Spinoza: Free Will and Freedom Baruch Spinoza (1632-1677) was a Dutch Jewish rationalist philosopher who is most famous for his Ethics and Theological-Political Treatise. Although influenced by Stoicism, Maimonides, Machiavelli, Descartes, and Hobbes, among others, he developed distinct and innovative positions on a number of issues in metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, politics, biblical hermeneutics, and theology. … Continue reading Spinoza on Free Will and Freedom