Laozi (Lao-tzu, fl. 6th cn. B.C.E.)

Laozi is the name of a legendary Daoist philosopher, the alternate title of the early Chinese text better known in the West as the Daodejing, and the moniker of a deity in the pantheon of organized “religious Daoism” that arose during the later Han dynasty (25-220 C.E.). Laozi is the pinyin romanization for the Chinese characters which mean “Old Master.” Laozi is also known as Lao Dan (“Old Dan”) in early Chinese sources (see Romanization systems for Chinese terms). The Zhuangzi (late 4^th century B.C.E.) is the first text to use Laozi as a personal name and to identify Laozi and Lao Dan. The earliest materials to mention Laozi are in the Zhuangzi’s Inner Chapters (Chs. 1-7) in the narration of Lao Dan’s funeral in Ch. 3. Two other passages provide support for the linkage of Laozi and Lao Dan (in Ch. 14 and Ch. 27). There are seventeen passages in which Laozi plays a role in the Zhuangzi. Three are in the Inner Chapters, eight occur in chapters 11-14 in the Yellow Emperor sections of the text (chs. 11, 12, 13, 14), five are in chapters likely belonging to Zhuang Zhou’s disciples as the sources (chs. 21, 22, 23, 25, 27), and one is in the final concluding editorial chapter (ch. 33). In the Yellow Emperor sections in which Laozi is the main figure, four passages contain direct attacks on Confucius and the Confucian virtues of ren, yi, and li in the form of dialogues. The sentiments expressed by Laozi in these passages are reminiscent of remarks from the Daodejing and probably date from the period in which that collection was reaching some near final form. Some of these themes include the advocacy of wu-wei, rejection of discursive reasoning and mind meddling, condemnation of making discriminations, and valorization of forgetting and fasting of the mind. The earliest ascriptions of authorship of the Daodejing to Laozi are in Han Feizi and the Huainanzi. Over time, Laozi became a principal figure in institutionalized forms of Daoism and he was often associated with the many transformations and incarnations of the dao itself.

Laozi and Lao Dan in the Zhuangzi
Laozi and the Daodejing
The First Biography and the Establishment of Laozi as the Founder of Daoism
The Ongoing Laozi Myth
References and Further Reading

1. Laozi and Lao Dan in the Zhuangzi

The Zhuangzi gives the following, probably fictional, account of Confucius‘s impression of Laozi:

“Master, you’ve seen Lao Dan—what estimation would you make of him?” Confucius said, “At last I may say that I have seen a dragon—a dragon that coils to show his body at its best, that sprawls out to display his patterns at their best, riding on the breath of the clouds, feeding on the yin and yang. My mouth fell open and I couldn’t close it; my tongue flew up and I couldn’t even stammer. How could I possibly make any estimation of Lao Dan!” Zhuangzi, Ch. 14

Laozi’s relationship to Confucius is a major part of the Zhuangzi‘s picture of the philosopher. Of the seventeen passages mentioning Laozi, Confucius figures as a dialogical partner or subject in nine. While it is clear that Confucius is thought to have a long way to go to become a zhenren (the Zhuangzi‘s way of speaking about the perfected person), Lao Dan seems to feel sorry for Confucius in his reply to Wuzhi “No-Toes” in Ch. 5, The Sign of Virtue Complete. Laozi recommends to Wuzhi that he try to release Confucius from the fetters of his tendency to make rules and human discriminations (for example, right/wrong; beautiful/ugly) and set him free to wander with the dao.

Lao Dan addresses Confucius by his personal name “Qiu” in three passages. Since such a liberty is one that only a person with seniority and authority would take, this style invites us to believe that Confucius was a student of Lao Dan’s and thereby acknowledged Laozi as an authority. In one of these passages in which Lao Dan uses Confucius’s personal name Qiu, he cautions Confucius against clever arguments and making plans and strategies with which to solve life’s problems, telling him that such rhetoricians are simply like nimble monkeys and rat catching dogs who are set aside when unable to perform (Ch. 12, Heaven and Earth). And on another occasion, Qiu claims that he knows the “six classics” thoroughly and that he has tried to persuade 72 kings to their truth, but they have been unmoved. Lao Dan’s reply is, “Good!” He tells Confucius not to occupy himself with such worn out ways, and to instead live the dao himself (Ch.14, Turning of Heaven).

In his later attempt to provide an actual biography of Laozi by Sima Qian (see below), Laozi’s vocation as a librarian figures prominently. If the ultimate source of this tradition is the Zhuangzi, we should not forget that the context of this record is as a component in the theme that Laozi taught Confucius, who was confused and having no success with his own teachings. Accordingly, the point of the story that mentions Laozi’s occupation as librarian or an archivist (ch. 13) is that Confucius’ writings, offered to Laozi by Confucius himself, are simply not worthy to be put into a library. We cannot be sure, then, that there is any real memory of Confucius’s occupation being preserved for us, as the story may be an entire fiction meant to make a point about the inadequacy of Confucius’s teachings.

Finally, in Ch.14, Turning of Heaven, Lao Dan makes a direct attack not only on the rules and regulations of Confucius, but also the teachings of the Mohists, and the veneration of the ancient emperors and legendary sages of the past, displaying his preference for experiential oneness with dao to any teaching or tradition of philosophers or great minds of the past.

2. Laozi and the Daodejing

The ways in which expressions of Laozi in the seventeen passages in which he occurs in the Zhuangzi sound like sentiments in the Daodejing (hereafter, DDJ) represent collectively one basis for the traditional association of Laozi as author of the text. For example, at Laozi’s funeral in Ch. 3, Qin Shi valorizes Laozi by saying that he accomplished much, without appearing to do so, which is a reference both to the Old Master’s rejection of pursuit of fame and power and also praise for his conduct as wu-wei (effortless action) in oneness with dao. Qin Shi’s praise of Laozi is also consistent with Laozi’s teaching to Yangzi Ju in Ch. 7 not to seek fame and power. Such conduct and attitudes are encouraged strongly in DDJ 2, 7, 22, 24, 51 and 77. When Laozi tells Wuzhi to return to Confucius and set him free from the disease of problematizing life and tying himself in knots by helping him to empty himself of making discriminations (Zhuangzi ch. 5), this same teaching shows up in the DDJ in many places (for example, chs. 5 and 18). Likewise, Laozi criticizes Confucius for trying to spread the classics (12 in number in ch. 13 and 6 in ch. 14) instead of valuing the wordless teaching, the DDJ has a ready parallel in Ch. 56. While Confucius is teaching his disciples to put forth effort and cultivate benevolence (ren) and appropriate conduct (yi), Laozi tells him that he should be teaching effortless action (wu-wei) in Zhuangzi chs. 13, 14, and 21). This teaching also shows up in the DDJ (chs. 2, 3, 20, 47, 48, 57, 63, and 64). Finally, if we take Zhuangzi Ch. 33 as an original part of the work, then Lao Dan (Laozi) actually quotes DDJ 28.

In addition to the ways in which Laozi’s teachings in the Zhuangzi sound like those of the DDJ, we should also note that both of the very early classical works known as the Hanfeizi and the Huainanzi contain passages that are direct quotes or unmistakable allusions to teachings in the DDJ and attribute them to Lao Dan or Laozi by name. Tae Hyun Kim has made a study of these passages in Hanfeizi and the recent English translation of Huainanzi by John Major and others makes it easy to locate these citations (for example, see Huainanzi, 11.3). All of these connections culminate in Sima Qian’s biography of Laozi (see below) which not only says that Laozi was the author of the DDJ, but explains that it was a written text of Laozi’s teachings given when he departed China to go to the West. So, by the 1st Cent. B.C.E., it was accepted by tradition and lore that Laozi was the author of the DDJ.

However, the attribution of authorship of the DDJ to Laozi is much more complicated than it first appears. The DDJ has 81 chapters and about 5,000 Chinese characters, depending on which text is used. Its two major divisions are the dao jing (chs. 1-37) and the de jing (chs. 38-81). But actually, this division probably rests on nothing other than the fact that the principal concept opening Chapter 1 is dao (way) and that of Chapter 38 is de (virtue). Moreover, although the text has been studied by commentators in Chinese history for centuries, the general reverence shown to it, and the long standing tradition that it was the work of the great philosopher Laozi, were two factors militating against any critical literary analysis of its structure. What we know now is that in spite of the view that the text had a single author named Laozi, it is clear to textual critics that the work is a collection of smaller passages edited into sections and not the work of a single hand. Most of these probably circulated orally, perhaps as single teachings or in small collections. Later they were gathered and arranged by an editor.

The internal structure of the DDJ is only one ground for the denial of a single author for the text. The fact that we also now know there were multiple versions of the DDJ, even as early as 300 B.C.E., also suggests that it is unlikely that a single author wrote just one book that we now know as the DDJ. Consider that for almost 2,000 years the Chinese text used by commentators in China and upon which all except the most recent Western language translations were based has been called the Wang Bi, after the commentator who made a complete edition of the DDJ sometime between 226-249 C.E. Although Wang Bi was not a Daoist, the commentary he wrote after collecting and editing the text became a standard interpretive guide, and generally speaking even today scholars depart from his arrangement of the actual text only when they can make a compelling argument for doing so. However, based on recent archaeological finds at Guodian in 1993 and Mawangdui in the 1970s we have no doubt that there were several simultaneously circulating versions of the DDJ text that pre-dated Wang Bi’s compilation of what we now call the “received text.”

Mawangdui is the name for a site of tombs discovered near Changsha in Hunan province. The Mawangdui discoveries include two incomplete editions of the DDJ on silk scrolls (boshu) now simply called “A” and “B.” These versions have two principal differences from the Wang Bi. Some word choice divergencies are present. The order of the chapters is reversed, with 38-81 in the Wang Bi coming before chapters 1-37 in the Mawangdui versions. More precisely, the order of the Mawangdui texts takes the traditional 81 chapters and sets them out like this: 38, 39, 40, 42-66, 80, 81, 67-79, 1-21, 24, 22, 23, 25-37. Robert Henricks has published a translation of these texts with extensive notes and comparisons with the Wang Bi under the title Lao-Tzu, Te-tao Ching.

The Guodian find consists of 730 inscribed bamboo slips found in a tomb near the village of Guodian in Hubei province in 1993. There are 71 slips with material that is also found in 31 of the 81 chapters of the DDJ and corresponding only to Chapters 1-66. Based on the probable date of the closing of the tomb, the version of the DDJ found within it may date as early as c. 300 B.C.E.

3. The First Biography and the Establishment of Laozi as the Founder of Daoism

We have now arrived at the stage where studies of Laozi’s biography usually begin.

The first known attempt to write a biography of Laozi is in the Shiji (Historical Records) by Sima Qian (145-89 B.C.E.). According to this text, Laozi was a native of Chu, a southern state of the Zhou dynasty. His surname was Li, and his personal name was Er, and his style name was Dan. Sima Qian reports that Laozi was a historiographer in charge of the archives of Zhou. Moreover, Sima Qian tells us that Confucius had traveled to see Laozi to learn about the performance of rituals from him. According to The Book of Rites (Liji), a master known as Lao Dan was an expert on mourning rituals. On four occasions, Confucius (Kongzi, Master Kong) is reported to have responded to questions by appealing to answers given by Lao Dan. The records even say that Confucius once assisted him in a burial service. Just what date we can put on this record from The Book of Rites is uncertain, but it may have informed Sima Qian’s biography.

According to the biography, during the course of their conversations Laozi told Confucius to give up his prideful ways and seeking of power. When Confucius returned to his disciples, he told them that he was overwhelmed by the commanding presence of Laozi, which was like that of a mighty dragon. The biography goes on to say that Laozi cultivated the dao and its de. However, as the state of Zhou continued to decline, Laozi decided to leave China through the Western pass (toward India) and that upon his departure he gave to the keeper of the pass, one Yin Xi, a book divided into two parts, one on dao and one on de, and of 5,000 characters in length. After that, no one knew what became of him. This is perhaps the most familiar of the traditions narrated by Sima Qian and it contains the core of most every subsequent biography or hagiography of Laozi of significance. However, the biography did not end here. Sima Qian went on to record what other sources said about Laozi.

In the first biography, Sima Qian says some report that Laolaizi came from Chu, was a contemporary of Confucius, and he authored a work in fifteen sections which speaks of the practical uses of the Daoist teachings. But Sima Qian leaves it undecided whether he thinks Laolaizi should be identified with Laozi, even if he does include this reference in the section on Laozi.

Sima Qian adds another layer to the biography without commenting on the degree of confidence he has in its truthfulness, according to which it is said that Laozi lived 160 years or even 200 years, as a result of cultivating the dao and nurturing his longevity.

An additional tradition included in the first biography is that Dan, the historiographer of Zhou predicted in 479 B.C.E. that Zhou and Qin would break apart and that a new king would arise from Qin. The point of this tradition is that Dan (Lao Dan?) had the power to predict the political future of the people, including the fragmentation of the Zhou dynasty and the rise of the Qin in about 221 B.C.E. (that is, Qinshihuang, or the first emperor of China). But Sima Qian likewise refuses to identify Laozi with this Dan.

Finally, the first biography concludes with a reference to Laozi’s son and his descendants. Another movement in the evolution of the Laozi story was completed by about 240 B.C.E. This was necessitated by Lao Dan’s association with the grand historiographer Dan during the Zhou, who predicted the rise of the Qin state. This information, along with that of Laozi’s journey to the West, and of the writing of the book for Yin Xi won a favorable position for Laozi during the Qin dynasty. The association of Laozi with a text (the DDJ) that was becoming increasingly significant was important. However, with the demise of the Qin state, some realignment of Laozi’s connection with them was needed. So, Qian’s final remarks about Laozi’s son helped to associate the philosopher’s lineage with the new Han ruling family. The journey to the West component now also had a new force. It explained why Laozi was not presently advising the Han rulers.

Overall, it seems that the earliest biography conforms closely to passages contained in Zhuangzi Chapters 11-14 and 26 in associating Laozi with the archivist or historiographer of Zhou, Laozi’s rebuke of Confucius’s prideful seeking of fame and pursuit of power, and the report that Confucius told his disciples that Laozi was like a great dragon. It is possible, then, that Zhuangzi is thus the ultimate source of Sima Qian’s information.

Sima Qian also says, “Laozi cultivated the dao and its virtue (de).” We recognize of course that “dao and its virtue” is Dao and de and that this phase is meant to solidify Laozi’s association with the Daode jing. What the Zhuangzi, Hanfeizi and Huainanzi only alluded to by putting near quotes from the DDJ in the mouth of Laozi, Sima Qian now makes into an explicit connection. He even tells us that when the Zhou kingdom began to decline, Laozi decided to leave China and head into the West. When he reached the mountain pass, the keeper of the pass (Yin Xi) insisted that he write down his teachings, so that the people would have them after he left. So, “Laozi wrote a book in two parts, discussing the ideas of the dao and of de in some 5,000 words, and departed. No one knows where he ended his life.” These remarks make an unmistakable connection between what Laozi is said to have delivered to Yin Xi and the two sectional divisions of the DDJ and a very close approximation to its exact number of characters.

Sima Qian classified the Six Schools as Yin-Yang, Confucian, Mohist, Legalists, School of Names, and Daoists. Since his biography located Laozi in a time period predating the Zhuangzi, and the passages in the Zhuangzi seemed to be about a person who lived in the time of Confucius (and not to be simply a literary or traditional invention), then the inference was easy to make that Laozi was the founder of the Daoist school.

4. The Ongoing Laozi Myth

In The Lives of the Immortals (Liexuan zhuan) by Liu Xiang (79-8 B.C.E.) there are separate entries for Laozi and Yin Xi. According to the extension of the story of Laozi’s leaving China through the Western pass found in Liu Xiang’s work, Yin became a disciple of Laozi and begged him to allow him to go to the West as well. Laozi told him that he could come along, but only after he cultivated the dao. Laozi instructed Yin to study hard and await a summons which would be delivered to him in the marketplace in the city of Chengdu. There is now a shrine at the putative location of this site dedicated to “ideal disciple.” Additionally, in Liu Xiang’s text it is clear that Laozi is valorized as the preeminent immortal and as a superior daoshi (fangshi) who had achieved not only immortality through wisdom and the practice of techniques for longevity, but also mastery of the arts associated with the abilities and skills of one who was united with dao (compare the “Spirit Man” living in the Gushe mountains in Zhuangzi ch. 1 and Wang Ni’s remarks on the perfected person or zhenren in ch. 2).

Another important stage in the development of Laozi’s place in Chinese philosophical history occurred when Emperor Huan (147-167 C.E.) built a palace on the traditional site of Laozi’s birthplace and authorized veneration and sacrifice to Laozi. The “Inscription to Laozi” (Laozi ming) written by Pian Shao in c. 166 C.E. as a commemorative marker for the site goes well beyond Sima Qian’s biography. It makes the first apotheosis of Laozi into a deity. The text makes reference to the many cosmic metamorphoses of Laozi, portraying him as having been counselor to the great sage kings of China’s misty pre-history. Accordingly, during this period of the 2^nd and 3^rd centuries, the elite at the imperial court divinized Laozi and regarded him as an embodiment or incarnation of the dao, a kind of cosmic emperor who knew how to bring things into perfect harmony and peace by acting in wu-wei.

The Daoist cosmological belief in the powers of beings who experienced unity with the dao to effect transformation of their bodies and powers (for example, Huzi in Zhuangzi, ch.7) was the philosophical underpinning of the work, Classic on the Transformations of Laozi (Laozi bianhua jing, late 100s C.E., available now in a Dunhuang manuscript dating 612 C.E.). This work reflects some of the ideas in Pian Shao’s inscription, but takes them even further. It tells how Laozi transformed into his own mother and gave birth to himself, taking quite literally comments in the DDJ where the dao is portrayed as the mother of all things (DDJ, ch. 1). The work associates Laozi with various manifestations or incarnations of the dao itself. In this text there is a complete apotheosis of Laozi into a numinal divinity. “Laozi rests in the great beginning, wanders in the great origin, floats through dark, numinous emptiness…He joins serene darkness before its opening, is present in original chaos before the beginnings of time….Alone and without relation, he has existed since before heaven and earth. Living deeply hidden, he always returns to be. Gone, the primordial; Present, a man” (Quoted in Kohn, “Myth,” 47). The final passage in this work is an address given by Laozi predicting his reappearance and promising liberation from trouble and the overthrow of the Han dynasty, an allusion that helps us fix the probable date of origin for the work. The millennial cults of the second century believed Laozi was a messianic figure who appeared to their leaders and gave them instructions and revelations (for example, the hagiography of Zhang Daoling, founder of the Celestial Master Zhengyi movement contained in the 5th century work, Taiping Guangji 8).

The period of the Celestial Masters (c. 142-260 C.E.) produced documents enhancing the myth of Laozi who came then to be called Laojun (Lord Lao) or Taishang Laojun (Most High Lord Lao). Laojun could manifest himself in any time of unrest and bring Great Peace (taiping). Yet, the Celestial Masters never claimed that Laojun had done so in their day. Instead of such a direct manifestation, the Celestial Masters practitioners taught that Laojun transmitted to them talismans, registers, and new scriptures in the form of texts to guide the creation of communities of heavenly peace. One work, very likely from the late 3^rd or early 4^th century C.E. entitled The Hundred and Eight Precepts Spoken by Lord Lao (Laojun shuo yibai bashi jie) became the earliest set of behavioral guides for Celestial Masters communities. According to the text, Laozi delivered these precepts after returning from India and finding the people in a state of corruption.

During the reign of Emperor Huidi of the Western Jin dynasty (290-306 C.E.), Wang Fu, a master within the Daoist sectarian group known as the Celestial Masters, often debated with the Buddhist monk Bo Yuan about philosophical beliefs. As a result of these exchanges, scholarly consensus holds that Wang Fu compiled a one scroll work entitled Classic of the Conversion of the Barbarians (Huahu jing, c. 300 C.E.). The work is also known by the title The Supreme Numinous Treasure’s Sublime Classic on Laozi’s Conversion of the Barbarians (Taishang lingbao Laozi huahu miaojing). Perhaps the most inflammatory claim of this work was its teaching that when Laozi left China through the Western pass he went to India, where he transmorphed into the historical Buddha and converted the barbarians. The basic implication of the book was that Buddhism was actually only a form of Daoism. This work inflamed Buddhists for decades. In fact, both of the Tang Emperors Gaozong (649-683 C.E.) and Zhongzong (705-710 C.E.) gave imperial orders to prohibit its distribution. However, as bitter contention continued between Buddhism and Daoism, the Daoists actually expanded the Classic of the Conversion of the Barbarians, so that by 700 C.E. it was ten scrolls in length. Four of these were recovered in the Dunhuang cache of manuscripts. The much extended work came to include the account that Laozi entered the mouth of a queen in India and the next year was born from her right arm-pit to become the Buddha. He walked immediately after his birth, and “from then on Buddhist teaching came to flourish.” To those familiar with the hagiographies of the Buddha, virtually all of this birth account is recognizable as associated with Buddha, not Laozi.

In the course of the production of polemical writings on the Buddhist side of the debate, attempts were made to turn the tables on the Daoists. Laozi was portrayed as a bodhisattva or disciple of the Buddha sent to convert the Chinese. This theory had other desirable extensions from a Buddhist viewpoint, because it was also applied to Confucius, enabling Buddhist rhetoricians to hold that Confucius was an avatar of Buddhism and that Confucianism was actually a form of distorted Buddhism.

Most later writings about Laozi continued to base their appeals to Laozi’s authority on his ongoing transformations, but they likewise provide evidence of the growing tension between Daoism and Buddhism. The first mythological account of Laozi’s birth is in the Classic of the Inner Explanation of the Three Heavens (Santian neijie jing), a Celestial Master work dated about 420 C.E. In this text, Laozi has three births: as the manifestation of the dao from pure energy to become a deity in heaven; in human form as the ancient philosopher author of the DDJ; and as the Buddha after his journey to the West. In the first birth, his mother is known as “The Jade Maiden of Mystery and Wonder.” In his second, he is born to a human woman known as Mother Li. This was an eighty-one year pregnancy, after which he was born from her left armpit (there is a tradition that Buddha had been born from his mother’s right arm pit). At birth he had white hair and so he was called laozi (here meaning something more like lao haizi or Old Child). This birth is set in the time of the Shang dynasty, several centuries before the date Sima Qian reports. But the purpose of such a move in the Laozi legend is to allow him time to travel to the West and then become the Buddha. The third birth takes place in India as the Buddha.

In the Yuan dynasty (1285 C.E.), Emperor Shizu ordered the burning of the Daoist canon of texts, and according to lore, the first writing destroyed was the greatly extended version of Classic of the Conversion of the Barbarians in ten or more scrolls. Once again, though, the text and its story of Laozi seemed quite resilient. It reappeared in the form of an illustrated work entitled Eighty-one Transformations of Lord Lao (Laojun bashiyi hua tushuo). The Buddhist thinker Xiangmai wrote a detailed, but polemical, history of this text and few scholars trust its reliability. Whether the Eighty-one Transformations of Lord Lao still survives is arguable, although a work entitled Eighty-one Transformations of the Most High Lord Lao of Mysterious Origin of the Golden Portal (Jinque xuanyuan Taishang Laojun baishiyi hua tushuo) with illustrations and dating to 1598 is held in the Museum fur Volkerkunde in Berlin. The version in Berlin provides an illustration for each of Laozi’s transformations, each accompanied by a short text. The first few depict his existence in cosmic time. It is not until the 11^th transformation that he enters historical time during the era of Fu Xi by the name Yuhuazi. In his 34^th transformation, Laozi sends Yin Xi to explain the sutras to the Indian barbarians. The 58^th transformation is Laozi’s appearance in the clouds to Zhang Daoling, the founder of the Celestial Master Zhengyi sect of Daoism that still exists today.

Ge Hong’s (283-343 C.E.) The Inner Chapters of the Master Who Embraces Simplicity (Baopuzi neipian) is arguably the most important Daoist philosophical work of the Jin dynasty. In this text, Ge Hong reports that in a state of visualization he saw Laozi, seven feet tall, with cloudlike garments of five colors, wearing a multi-tiered cap and carrying a sharp sword. According to Ge Hong, Laozi had a prominent nose, long eyebrows, and an elongated head. This physiological type was the template for portraying immortals in Daoist art. Whereas Liu Xiang’s Collected Biographies of the Immortals (Liexian zhuan, c. 18 B.C.E.) reports that Laozi was born during the Shang dynasty, served as an archivist under the Zhou, was a teacher of Confucius, and later made his way to the West just as said in Sima Qian’s standard biography, Ge Hong also collected and edited the Biographies of Immortals (Shenxian zhuan). According to the article on Laozi, Ge Hong praises Laozi’s practice of stillness and wu-wei, but he also represents Laozi as a master of the techniques of immortality and the efficacy of external alchemy, herbs and control of qi. He attributes to Laozi what is called the alchemy of the nine cinnabars and eight minerals, as well as a vast knowledge of herbology and dietetics. Ge Hong also tells a story about one Xu Jia who was a retainer of Laozi. In the story, Laozi keeps Xu Jia alive by means of a powerful talisman placed in Xu’s mouth. Its removal causes Xu’s death. When replaced, Xu Jia lives again. In all this, Laozi is portrayed as a master of life and death by means of talismanic power, a practice used by the Celestial Masters and continued by Daoist masters as late as the Ming dynasty, if not into the present era.

Other reported manifestations of Laozi gave authority to new Daoist lineages or modifications of practice. For example, the Daoist master Kou Qianzhi reported a revelation received from Laozi in 415 C.E. which was a “New Code” for Daoist practitioners and communities. He wrote down the revelation in a text that became known as Classic on Precepts of Lord Lao Recited to the Melody of the Clouds (Laojun yinsong jiejing). This text contains 36 moral precepts each of which trace their authority to the introductory phrase, “Lord Lao said….” Textual traces are not the only sources for the traditions and views of Laozi in Chinese philosophical history. Yoshiko Kamitsuka has done a study of how views about Laozi changed and been reflected in material culture, especially sculpture and inscription.

Laozi was also often looked to for political validation. Throughout most of the Tang dynasty (618-907 C.E.), Laozi was regarded as the protector of the state because of the tradition that both the Tang ruling family and Laozi shared the surname Li and because of many reports of auspicious appearances of Laozi at the inauguration of the Tang dynasty in which he pledged his support during the rise and solidification of the ruling bureaucracy.

The hagiography of Laozi has continued to develop, down to the present day. There are even traditions that various natural geographic landmarks and features are the enduring imprint of Lord Lao on China and his face can be seen in them. It is more likely, of course, that Laozi’s immortality is in the mark made by the philosophical movement he has come to represent and the culture it created.

5. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger. (1998). Wandering at Ease in the Zhuangzi. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Bokenkamp, Stephen R. (1997). Early Daoist Scriptures. Berkeley: University of California Press.
Boltz, William. (2005). “The Composite Nature of Early Chinese Texts.” In Text and Ritual in Early China, ed. Martin Kern. 50-78. Seattle: University of Washington Press.
Csikszentmihalyi, Mark and Ivanhoe, Philip J., eds. (1999). Religious and Philosophical Aspects of the Laozi. Albany: State University of New York.
Giles, Lionel. (1948). A Gallery of Chinese Immortals. London: John Murray.
Graham, Angus. (1981). Chuang tzu: The Inner Chapters. London: Allen & Unwin.
Graham, Angus. (1989). Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China. La Salle, IL: Open Court.
Graham, Angus. [1998 (1986)], “The Origins of the Legend of Lao Tan.” In Lao-tzu and the Tao-te-ching, ed. Kohn, Livia Kohn and Michael LaFargue, 23-41. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Hansen, Chad. (1992). A Daoist Theory of Chinese Thought. New York: Oxford University Press.
Henricks, Robert. (1989). Lao-Tzu: Te-Tao Ching. New York: Ballantine.
Ivanhoe, Philip J. (2002). The Daodejing of Laozi. New York: Seven Bridges Press.
Kamitsuka, Yoshiko, (1998). “Lao-Tzu in Six Dynasties Taoist Sculpture.” In Lao-tzu and the Tao-te-ching, ed. Kohn, Livia Kohn and Michael LaFargue, 63-89. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Kim, Tae Hyun. (2010). “Other Laozi Parallels in the Hanfeizi An Alternative Approach to the Textual History of the Laozi and Early Chinese Thought.” Sino-Platonic Papers 199 (March 2010), ed. Victor H. Mair. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
Kohn, Livia (2008). “Laojun yinsong jiejing [Classic on Precepts of Lord Lao, Recited to the Melody in the Clouds].” In Encyclopedia of Taoism, ed. Fabrizio Pregadio. London: Routledge.
Kohn, Livia, (1998). “The Lao-Tzu Myth.” In Lao-tzu and the Tao-te-ching, ed. Kohn, Livia Kohn and Michael LaFargue, 41-63. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Kohn, Livia, (1996). “Laozi: Ancient Philosopher, Master of Longevity, and Taoist God.” In Religions of China in Practice, ed. Donald S. Lopez, 52-63. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Kohn, Livia and LaFargue, Michael. (1998). Lao-tzu and the Tao-te-ching. Albany: State University of New York Press.
Kohn, Livia and Roth, Harold (2002) Daoist Identity: History, Lineage, and Ritual. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press.
Nylan, Michael and Csikzentmihalyi, Mark. (2003). “Constructing Lineages and Inventing Traditions through Exemplary Figures in Early China.” T’oung Pao 89: 1-41.
Penny, Benjamin (2008). “Laojun bashiyi huatu [Eighty-one Transformations of Lord Lao].” In Encyclopedia of Taoism, ed. Fabrizio Pregadio. London: Routledge.
Penny, Benjamin (2008). “Laojun shuo yibai bashi jie [The 180 Precepts Spoken by Lord Lao].” In Encyclopedia of Taoism, ed. Fabrizio Pregadio. London: Routledge.
Smith, Kidder (2003). “Sima Tan and the Invention of Daoism, ‘Legalism,’ et cetera.” The Journal of Asian Studies 62.1: 129-156.
Watson, Burton. (1968). The Complete Works of Chuang Tzu. New York: Columbia University Press.
Welch, Holmes. (1966). Taoism: The Parting of the Way. Boston: Beacon Press.
Welch, Holmes and Seidel, Anna, eds. (1979). Facets of Taoism. New Haven: Yale University Press.

Author Information

Ronnie Littlejohn
Email: ronnie.littlejohn@belmont.edu
Belmont University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy