Philosophy of Mathematical Practice

The philosophy of mathematical practice (PMP) is a branch of the philosophy of mathematics that is motivated by, and closely engaged with, mathematical practice. Studies in this area take as their starting point questions that arise in the practice of mathematics, such as how to examine problematic concepts like infinity, what counts as a proof, and how mathematical understanding should be characterized. Moreover, philosophical discussions of such issues should be grounded in relevant mathematical content.

Different interpretations of practice shape work in PMP. One interpretation understands practice as referring to the activities of human beings. According to this view, mathematical knowledge is shaped through various forms of mathematical activity. Another interpretation emphasizes that philosophical inquiry must engage with mathematical content, such as its concepts, results, and methods. Finally, a historical approach regards mathematics, its theories, and its concepts as shaped by human agents in diverse cultures and social settings. This latter perspective opens a range of topics that intersect with work in the philosophy and history of mathematics.

In addition to being informed by studies of mathematics more generally, PMP draws on and is informed by a range of other fields, including cognitive science, social science, and mathematics education.

This article introduces the central motivations, methods, and themes of PMP and explores three major areas in which it has proved fruitful: mathematical reasoning and proof, mathematical explanation, and visual thinking in mathematics.

Introduction
Mathematical Reasoning and Proof
Mathematical Explanations
Visual Thinking in Mathematics
1. Diagrams in the History of Mathematics
2. The Effectiveness of Diagrams
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The emergence of PMP as an orientation within the philosophy of mathematics began in the early 21^st century—and there are different interpretations of what PMP entails depending on how practice is understood. One way to characterize PMP is to contrast it with a narrower conception of philosophy of mathematics that focuses on issues related to mathematical foundations and ontology, and which restricts the epistemology of mathematics by tying it to the problem of access to mathematical entities as conceived in platonistic accounts of mathematical ontology. This narrower approach emphasizes the use of formal methods, often extending into fields beyond mathematics (compare: mathematical philosophy). While not denying the meaningfulness of the previous issues, PMP’s focus on practice suggests several possible key differences:

Expanded scope of inquiry: PMP extends the range of topics to be studied as part of philosophy of mathematics. It deals with questions related to aspects of the growth of mathematical knowledge, explanations, and mathematical applications—topics that go beyond the traditional focus on foundations and ontology.
Asking specific questions: The aim of PMP is, in a sense, modest: It does not necessarily seek to answer grand questions such as “what is the nature of mathematical knowledge?” or “what is the correct foundation of mathematics?”; rather, it investigates questions with a more specific scope of the kind mentioned in the previous item.
Engagement with mathematical content: Philosophical enquires draw on relevant mathematical content (going beyond elementary arithmetic and set theory), either from historical or contemporary mathematical practice.
Not idealized mathematics: Engagement with “real” mathematics can be seen in contrast to considering, or taking as starting point, idealized views on mathematics such as “mathematical statements are necessarily true,” or considering mathematical proofs exclusively as formal proofs.
Mathematics as an activity: PMP may consider mathematics as an activity rather than merely as a static body of theories.
Focusing on human agents: It emphasizes the role of human agents (individually and in communities), their practices and abilities, and how these affect mathematics.
Interdisciplinary connections: PMP draws on insights from, and interacts with, a range of other fields. In addition to being informed by studies of mathematics more generally, it has strong ties to the history of mathematics. Other relevant fields include cognitive science, social science, and mathematics education.
Extension of methods: In addition to employing methods of conceptual analysis familiar from analytic philosophy, PMP also relies on the analysis of specific case studies and may refer to empirical studies.

The above items describe tendencies and that PMP studies will typically include features mentioned in some of these items, but not all of them at once.

Although studies in PMP might draw on other fields and refer to empirical work, the overall aim remains philosophical. The methodology of enquiry is often that of analytic philosophy (Mancosu 2008a) and strives to formulate general claims about mathematics (Panza 2024). D’Alessandro (2025) discusses the use of empirical studies within what he calls “practice‑based approaches to the philosophy of mathematics.” His examples illustrate how empirical results should not be treated. When conducting case studies or empirical investigations, it is particularly important to carefully consider what kinds of (general) conclusions can reasonably be drawn from them and how these conclusions can be situated within a broader philosophical framework. Related issues concern how to pick which cases to study and to formulate a methodology. A proposal found in San Mauro and Venturi (2015) offers a general methodology and illustrates its use by analyzing the notion of naturalness in mathematics.

The remainder of this introduction gives a brief overview of PMP. The rest of the article presents in more detail three well-developed topics within PMP: mathematical reasoning and proofs, mathematical explanations, and visual thinking in mathematics. These examples are intended to show how the perspectives mentioned above are reflected in actual philosophical inquiry. The conclusion summarizes which features appear in each of the three topics. Note that the presentation of these topics is necessarily selective, as it is impossible to cover all aspects within the scope of this article.

a. Development and Motivation

A forerunner of PMP is Imre Lakatos’ Proofs and Refutations (1976). In the introduction, Lakatos criticizes the then dominant focus on the foundations of mathematics, referring to David Hilbert’s formalist school of thought. Lakatos finds that it has important limitations:

…[T]here are problems which fall outside the range of metamathematical abstractions. Among these are all problems relating to informal (inhaltliche) mathematics and to its growth, and all problems relating to the situational logic of mathematical problem-solving.…

…Formalism denies the status of mathematics to most of what has been commonly understood to be mathematics, and can say nothing about its growth. None of the ‘creative’ periods and hardly any of the ‘critical’ periods of mathematical theories would be admitted into the formalist heaven, where mathematical theories dwell like the seraphim, purged of all the impurities of earthly uncertainty (1976, 1-2).

As is well known, Lakatos presents the development of mathematical knowledge as a dynamic and ongoing process of conjectures, proofs, and refutations. Crucially, his account is grounded in a historical reconstruction of the debates surrounding Euler’s formula for polyhedra, illustrating how mathematical concepts evolve through dialogue, criticism, and revision.

Another early forerunner of PMP is the group of philosophers, historians, and mathematicians that called themselves the “mavericks” (Aspray and Kitcher 1988). Mancosu characterizes the maverick tradition by three key features:

anti-foundationalism, that is, there is no certain foundation for mathematics; mathematics is a fallible activity;
anti-logicism, that is, mathematical logic cannot provide the tools for an adequate analysis of mathematics and its development;
attention to mathematical practice: only detailed analysis and reconstruction of large and significant parts of mathematical practice can provide a philosophy of mathematics worth its name (2008a, 5).

Putnam’s (1967) “Mathematics without Foundations” can be seen as an early expression of anti-foundationalist ideas corresponding to the first item. The mathematician Hersh has developed a related view of mathematics, arguing that mathematics is best understood as a historically evolving and social human practice rather than as a discipline grounded in ultimate foundations or in a realm of independently existing abstract objects (1997, 2013). The collection New Directions in the Philosophy of Mathematics, edited by Tymoczko, consists of a variety of contributions, some of which explicitly mention all three features. The preface criticizes the dominant perspectives on foundations in the philosophy of mathematics—stating that it is unable to “articulate the actual experience of mathematicians” (1998, ix).

Although philosophers of mathematical practice agree on the importance of attending to actual mathematical practice, not all of them embrace the first two features of the maverick orientation: anti-foundationalism and anti-logicism. That is, they do not advocate a complete rejection of logic or the use of formal tools in philosophical enquiries. On the contrary, many PMP scholars assert the value of foundational work, see Mancosu (2008a); Van Bendegem (2014), and argue that studies on the foundations of mathematics can be pursued in the spirit of PMP. See below and Carter (2019) for examples. Moreover, they emphasize that engaging with mathematical foundations proper requires sophisticated knowledge of specific mathematical theories as well as involvement with mathematical practice.

In conclusion, whereas early scholars regarded studies of mathematical practice as a critical alternative to the dominant studies of mathematical foundations, in 2026 most contemporary philosophers of mathematical practice consider it as an approach to the philosophy of mathematics which extends the range of studied topics.

b. What Does Practice Mean?

In addition to the variety of features mentioned above, differing interpretations of practice shape work within PMP. The survey paper “Philosophy of Mathematical Practice – Motivations, Themes and Prospects” (Carter 2019) identifies three different though often overlapping interpretations: the activities of human agents, studies of mathematics itself (that is, mathematical content), and a historical perspective that views mathematics as shaped by particular practices.

The first interpretation understands practice as referring to the activities of human beings. According to this view, mathematics and mathematical knowledge are shaped through various forms of human activity (Ferreirós 2016, 2024). This includes proto-mathematical activities, constructing elementary mathematics through counting and measuring, and mathematical activities relying on external representations. Representations can take the form of physical tools, such as an abacus, a calculator, or inscriptions, including notational systems and visual representations like diagrams.

There are also positions on the ontology of mathematics which take as a starting point that mathematical objects or theories are either posited by human agents (Cole 2013) or are the outcome of their activities (Ferreirós 2016). Cole argues that even though mathematical entities are socially constructed they are nevertheless genuine existents in the sense that they are objective, atemporal, and exist by necessity. In contrast, Ferreirós argues that the mathematical theories that go beyond the natural numbers build on (partly) hypothetical assumptions. According to Ferreirós, the objectivity of mathematics is compatible with its hypothetical nature. Cantù and Testa (2023) present a comprehensive overview of these and other related positions that combine social ontology with mathematical practice.

A second take on practice emphasizes that philosophical inquiry must engage with mathematical content, such as the concepts, theories, results, or methods occurring in mathematical practice. This orientation is exemplified by Mancuso in The Philosophy of Mathematical Practice (2008). Mancosu motivates it as:@

Certain philosophical problems become salient only when the appropriate area of mathematics is taken into consideration.…Finally, certain areas of mathematics can actually provide the philosophy of mathematics with useful tools for addressing important philosophical problems (2008a, 2).

The contributions in Mancosu (2008) belong mainly to the epistemology of mathematics, but questions concerning the ontology of mathematics and foundations may also be examined from this perspective. Although studies of mathematical content may not be able to provide answers about the true nature of mathematical objects, there are other and related questions that can be considered from a practice point of view. For example, Avigad and Morris (2016) examine the gradual introduction of the concept of a “character” in proofs of Dirichlet’s theorem about primes in arithmetic progressions. A Dirichlet character is a certain type of function, and it appears only implicitly in Dirichlet’s original proof from 1857. This observation leads the authors to discuss the underlying reasons for our ontological posits, as exemplified by the concept of function. In light of the fact that definitions often take years to crystallize and that multiple definitions of the same concept frequently coexist one might further ask: “What are the reasons for choosing one definition of a concept over another—is there something like a “natural” definition in mathematics?” (Tappenden 2008; San Mauro and Venturi 2015). Coumans (2024) offers a general exposition on definitions and concepts in mathematics.

Finally, one might adopt a historical approach, considering mathematics, its concepts, and theories as shaped by the activities of human agents in diverse cultures and social settings. A historical perspective opens a range of interesting philosophical considerations. From one angle, the history of mathematics can provide relevant case studies for philosophical inquiry. For example, if one wishes to investigate questions related to the growth of mathematics, historical cases can serve as valuable sources of insight. In contrast, one might be interested in the historical and mathematical circumstances that contributed to shifts in how mathematicians think about their subject. One could, for instance, examine what motivated the concern with mathematical foundations around the turn of the 20th century. Ferreirós and Gray (2006) offers several answers to this question. As another example, scholars interested in mathematical structuralism have traced structuralist ideas back to the 19th century, noting that a variety of pre‑structuralist views were formulated by both mathematicians and philosophers (Reck and Schiemer 2020).

c. Topics

In addition to the three topics—proofs, explanations, and visual thinking—that are presented below, a few other main trends that exemplify the range and depth of work in PMP are mentioned.

Following in the footsteps of Lakatos, philosophers—sometimes in collaboration with historians—have examined questions concerning the growth of mathematical knowledge. The volume The Growth of Mathematical Knowledge (Grosholz and Breger 2000) brings together a range of contributions addressing this theme. Central questions include how to characterize mathematical progress and how to define analogy and abstraction to clarify their roles in the development of mathematics.

Another route for exploring the growth of mathematical knowledge is to consider whether signs such as notations or visual representations contribute to mathematical discovery. From this perspective, mathematics is viewed as an activity carried out by human agents, and the form in which information is presented may influence what one can notice. While some have claimed that mathematics concerns ideas rather than the signs used to express them, others argue that notation plays a significant role in shaping mathematics and guiding mathematical thought (Brown 2008, chap. 6; Colyvan 2012, chap. 8; Macbeth 2014). Waszek (2024) suggests that the former view stems from a conception of mathematics as being conceptual. The view is prominent among Bourbaki members and is said to have its origin in late 19th century German mathematics, most notably from Dirichlet, Riemann, Dedekind, and E. Noether. A systematic approach to the study of mathematical notations is proposed by Schlimm (2025).

In addition to examining whether signs contribute to the development of mathematics, philosophers also note that multiple systems of signs often exist for the same mathematical object and seek to understand why this is the case. A good case study is provided by the different notational systems that have been developed in the history of logic, ranging from Frege’s twodimensional conceptual notation and Peirce’s diagrammatic existential graphs to the contemporary linear expressions (Shin 2002; Schlimm 2018; Waszek and Schlimm 2021). There are also cases in which different notations are used at the same time, sometimes seemingly interchangeably, as with the notations for the differential quotient \(f’\) and \(\frac{df}{dx}\). Analyzing an example from contemporary mathematics, Elworth (2026) argues that the different notations under consideration offer distinct types of affordances (borrowing a term from psychology). They differ in terms of what information can be read off and how they are manipulated, which in turn affects how computations are carried out. Similar issues also emerge when considering how stylistic elements in mathematics offer distinct types of characterizations of the “same” mathematical entities, each favoring different developments; see Granger (1968) and Mancosu (2025).

The last topic mentioned in this section is mathematical structuralism, which is an excellent example of a philosophical position that is inspired by the practice of mathematics. Noticing that mathematicians refer to their subject as the study of structures, philosophers have articulated various theories of mathematical structuralism focusing on the ontology of mathematics (for an overview see Reck and Schiemer (2025).) Slogans of structuralism are that “mathematics is the study of structures,” that is, relations rather than objects, and that “mathematical objects as places in structures have only structural properties.” Some of the initial characterizations have given rise to further questions and dilemmas. For example, the realist versions of structuralism entail that it is not possible to distinguish between supposedly different entities such as the complex numbers i and -i, the so-called identity problem (Reck and Schiemer 2025). As pointed out in McLarty (2020), mathematics itself holds a solution to this problem: Distinguishing between the two numbers depends on which structure the numbers are considered part of. If the complex numbers are considered as an algebraic structure it is not possible—but if they are part of complex analysis (for example, considering them as points of the complex plane) there is a way to distinguish them.

In contrast to discussing metaphysical implications of structuralism, one may consider structuralism from a methodological point of view. Reck and Schiemer contrast philosophical structuralism with methodological structuralism which intends “to capture a distinctive way of doing mathematics, i.e., a certain ‘methodology,’ ‘form of practice,’ or ‘mathematical style’” (2020, 5). Conceiving of mathematics as an activity, one might note that structure (and the related notion of relation) refers in a broader sense than simply to the structure of natural numbers or algebraic structures such as groups or rings. First, mathematicians construct structures, for example, by identifying general properties of a collection of instances that can then serve as axioms defining the structure (Bourbaki 1950). Second, one considers relations between structures, either structures of the same kind as in the isomorphism theorems of algebra, or globally, forming relations across domains. One can also interpret relations as logical relations and consider alternative ways to structure a theory (compare: Hilbert’s axiomatic method). Third, mathematics as a whole can be organized in various ways (compare: Bourbaki’s city metaphor 1950). In this case one might focus on how mathematics is built from Bourbaki’s three mother structures and how different mathematical theories relate to each other. Fourth, mathematicians refer to structure theorems in the sense that a type of entity such as a finite abelian group can be classified by being identified (up to isomorphism) with direct sums of simpler groups (Carter 2024, sec. 2; Reck and Schiemer 2025).

Since contemporary mathematics does not only study individual structures, but relations between them, some scholars argue that category theory with its concepts of morphisms and functors is the natural framework for mathematical structuralism (McLarty 1993; Hellman 2003; Awodey 2004). Moreover, there are a number of alternative foundations for mathematics, formulated in category theoretical terms, including Homotopy Type Theory (Awodey 2014). An overview of category theoretical foundations in mathematics is Landry and Marquis (2005).

Some key features of PMP conclude this introduction. First, there is the guiding principle that philosophical inquiry takes mathematical practice as its starting point. Questions may arise within mathematics itself, prompted by internal developments and conceptual challenges—they may also be motivated by attempts to understand observed practices or to make sense of mathematicians’ own claims about mathematics. Second, there is the requirement that such inquiry be conducted with attention to relevant aspects of practice—that is, that analyses be informed by mathematical content, methodology, or what mathematicians actually do.

2. Mathematical Reasoning and Proof

Mathematics is generally regarded as the most rigorous of the sciences. One reason for this is that, unlike many other fields, mathematical claims are justified by proofs. A proof is typically described as given by a sequence of logical deductions based on a set of axioms. If the axioms are true and only valid inference rules are applied, then the conclusion is guaranteed to be true.

However, by looking at mathematical practice one finds that the proofs presented in textbooks, articles, and lectures rarely appear in this strict form. These so-called informal proofs are more diverse in structure, presentation, and goal. This observation raises several questions, which are explored through three main themes. The first theme examines the idea that mathematical proofs are considered rigorous because they are, in principle, formalizable. The second—closely related—theme investigates how diagrammatic proofs fit into this framework. The final theme considers the role of computers in the formulation and verification of mathematical proofs.

Overviews, monographs, collections: Mathematical Rigour and Informal Proof by Tanswell (2024) discusses various alternative descriptions of proofs from a practice point of view. The section “Proof” in the Handbook of the History and Philosophy of Mathematical Practices (Sriraman 2024) contains articles presenting different perspectives, including including Azzouni’s contribution on the algorithmic-device view on proofs.

a. Standard View of Proof

The first topic centers on what is commonly referred to as the standard view of proof (SVP). According to this view, mathematical proofs are—or should be—formalizable. This means that, in principle, any mathematical proof can be converted into a formal proof within a suitable formal system, provided that enough detail is supplied. A formal proof is defined as a sequence of well-formed formulas (wffs), where each wff is either an axiom or follows from earlier wffs in the sequence by means of an inference rule of the formal system. Note that how a proof is defined depends on the considered system. Proofs in natural deduction systems and sequent calculi are in general constituted by trees rather than linear sequences. But the general idea holds nevertheless.

As of 2026, SVP appears to be widely held among both 20th century and contemporary mathematicians; for example, see Mac Lane (1986) and Bayer et al. (2024). The influential group of mathematicians under the pseudonym Nicolas Bourbaki (1968) expresses it as follows:

In practice, the mathematician who wishes to satisfy himself of the perfect correctness or “rigour” of a proof or a theory … is content to bring the exposition to a point where his experience and mathematical flair tell him that translation into formal language would be no more than an exercise of patience (though doubtless a very tedious one) (1968, 8).

As noted earlier, most proofs encountered in mathematical practice do not resemble formal proofs. This raises questions about the relationship between informal and formal proofs. What does it actually mean to say that a proof is formalizable? Responses range from claiming that it merely expresses an ideal that is never or rarely executed in practice, to the view that it entails the actual existence of a formal proof:

An informal mathematical statement is a theorem if and only if its formal counterpart has a formal derivation […] a judgement as to correctness is tantamount to a judgment as to the existence of a formal derivation” (Avigad 2021, 7379; emphasis added).

Alternatively, Hamami (2022) suggests it means that there are routine translations that would turn informal proofs into their formal counterparts.

While some philosophers defend SVP and explore how informal proofs relate to formal ones, others argue that the view fails to capture essential features of mathematical practice. Critics of SVP often highlight other virtues besides rigour that are absent in the formal counterparts of proofs. One such virtue is explanatory value, which is discussed in the next section.

Notably, some scholars emphasize the contentual dimension of informal proofs that is of vital importance for human understanding. This includes claims of proofs as carriers of ideas and their interconnections (Rav 2007; Thurston 1994) and that they play a role in the development of new methods and techniques (Rav 1999).

To illustrate these claims, consider the following two proofs (adapted from Rav 2007):

The neutral element of a group is unique.

Proof: Suppose \(e_{1}\)and \(e_{2}\) are both neutral elements of a group, G. This entails for all \(g \in G\) that \(e_{i} \cdot g=g \cdot e_{i}=g\) for \(i=1,2\). The following then holds: \(e_{1}=e_{1} \cdot e_{2}=e_{2}\).

The set of real numbers is uncountable.

Proof sketch: We assume that the set of real numbers between zero and one [0;1] is countable. This means that its elements can be represented as a sequence enumerated by the natural numbers. Let \(d_{i}=\left(a_{ij}\right) for i, j \in \mathbb{N}\) be such a sequence:

\(d_{1}=(0,a_{11}a_{12}a_{13} \ldots )\), \(d_{2}=(0,a_{21}a_{22}a_{23} \ldots )\), \(d_{3}=(0,a_{31}a_{32}a_{33} \ldots )\),…

We now construct a real number in [0;1], \(b=(b_{i}),\) that is different from all entries of the sequence \(d_{i}\), which contradicts the assumption that the real numbers can be enumerated. The element is constructed by choosing \(b_{i}\) different from \(a_{ii}\); that is, if the whole sequence is written down, \(b_{i}\) is different from each element along the diagonal entries. The conclusion is that the set [0;1] is not countable and therefore that the set of real numbers cannot be countable either.

Most likely, the reader is already convinced by the informal version of the first algebraic proof. Perhaps the reader also thinks it looks like a formal proof. However, if it were to be converted into a formal proof using only the axioms of a first-order logical system, along with the axioms of group theory, the result would take up approximately 30 lines (Rav 2007, 306). Moreover, the formulas would be devoid of content, the first equality, for example, looking something like this: \(\left(f_{2}^{2}\left(a_{i},x\right)=f_{2}^{2}\left(x,a_{i}\right)\right)\). (In this formula, the intended interpretation of \(f_{2}^{2}\) is multiplication and \(a_{i}, i=1,2\) corresponds to the neutral elements.)

The second proof, by contrast, draws heavily on contentual information. It relies on the idea that real numbers in the interval [0;1] can be expressed in decimal form—that is, as infinite sequences of digits between 0 and 9. It also invokes the concept of equinumerosity between the real numbers and the interval. Crucially, the proof employs a method: altering each diagonal entry when constructing the real number \(b\). This technique is used in later proofs, most famously in Gödel’s proof of the first incompleteness theorem. Finally, the proof is based on a construction, a feature that plays a central role in mathematical reasoning but is not captured by formal proofs. None of these aspects—contentual insight, method, or construction—are reflected in the purely syntactic structure of formal derivations.

In addition to criticizing SVP, some scholars have proposed alternative accounts of what constitutes a mathematical proof, along with explanations of how such proofs can still be considered rigorous. These accounts often emphasize that proofs serve purposes beyond mere rigor in mathematical practice. A prominent example is found in Lakatos’ Proofs and Refutations (1976). In his concept of a proof-generated theorem, the proof contributes to the very formulation of the theorem—by, for instance, suggesting definitions of key concepts or delimiting their domain of applicability.

Characterizations of proofs in practice include those by Hamami and Morris (2021), Azzouni (2024), and Tanswell (2024). Both Hamami and Morris, as well as Tanswell, describe proofs in terms of activities. Hamami and Morris view a proof as an activity carried out by a human agent according to a plan. One important feature of this plan is modularity—the idea that a proof consists of distinct parts that can be carried out in different steps. Tanswell offers a related metaphor, likening a proof to a “cooking recipe”: a sequence of actions that the reader is expected to perform. This view is supported by a corpus study of textbook language, in which Inglis and Tanswell (2024) find that imperatives such as “let,” “consider,” and “define” are frequently used in proofs. Based on this, they argue that the language of proofs often reads more like a set of instructions than a series of assertions—contrary to the definition of formal derivation that sees proofs as sequences of statements. See also Tanswell (2024, 44).

b. Diagram-Based Proofs

One of the challenges in connection with SVP is the existence of diagram-based proofs, that is, cases where a proof explicitly relies on, or reads off information from a diagram. As shown below in the section on visual thinking, the prevailing view among philosophers and mathematicians at the end of the 19th century and for much of the 20th century was that proofs should not depend on diagrams. In contrast, philosophers of mathematical practice object that proofs in both ancient and contemporary mathematics do refer to and include diagrams. This observation has led to different sorts of inquiries. Following the above discussions, adherents of SVP need to explain how diagram-based proofs are reducible to formal proofs (Avigad 2021). Similarly, when formulating alternative versions of proof, philosophers need to account for how these alternatives accommodate diagram-based proof. Tanswell (2024), for example, explains how the recipe model of proof applies to “picture” proofs—that is, proofs that consist merely of pictures or diagrams. He illustrates the point by showing a proof of Pythagoras’ theorem which is supplied with arrows that direct readers’ attention.

In a series of papers, De Toffoli and Giardino document the use of diagrammatic proofs in contemporary topology and argue that they play an epistemic role (Giardino 2024). Moreover, De Toffoli (2022) argues that some diagrams constitute a kind of notation and thereby can play a non-redundant role in proofs. She further claims there are different types of diagrams in contemporary mathematical practice, introducing a distinction between geometric-topological (GT) and algebraic diagrams. Commutative diagrams used in algebraic topology and category theory are obviously different from diagrams in topology and related fields, and these differences are reflected in practice. The former belongs to the class of algebraic diagrams, which means they essentially work as a two-dimensional algebraic notation. In contrast, the interpretation of GT diagrams depends on their visual properties. Consider as an example Euler diagrams where set inclusion is represented by containment, that is, a circle containing another. De Toffoli claims that diagrams can play a non-redundant role in proofs but also that they can be essential to the proofs in which they figure. He also argues that even though proofs based on diagrams can be converted into diagram-free counterparts, these latter proofs will be different in terms of content.

c. Mathematical Proofs and Computers

The use of computers as tools in mathematics—sometimes referred to as experimental mathematics—introduces further aspects to the discussion of what constitutes a proof. It should be noted that if “experiment” is interpreted as the formulation and testing of hypotheses or as computations searching for patterns, then mathematics has relied upon experimental methods long before there were computers. Moreover, tools of various kinds—ranging from the abacus to the contemporary pen and paper—have been employed throughout history (Avigad 2018). A few key aspects of the use of computers in mathematical practice such as the use of proof assistants and the emergence of large language models (LLMs) follows—beginning with the topic of experimental mathematics as it was understood at the end of the 20th century.

The first major example of using computers to prove a mathematical theorem is Appel, Haken, and Koch’s computer proof of the four-color theorem (4CT) in the 1970s. The 4CT states that four colors suffice if you wish to color a map so that neighboring countries have different colors. The problem was originally mentioned by a student to De Morgan in 1852. Unable to solve the problem, De Morgan told his colleagues about it. In 1879 the problem was thought to be solved by A.B. Kempe until J. Heawood found a flaw in the argument. The four-color problem has been a major influence in the development of graph-theory (Biggs, Lloyd, and Wilson 2006). Appel, Haken, and Koch’s proof begins by reducing—using traditional mathematical arguments—the number of cases that need to be checked to a finite, but large, number of configurations. A computer is then used to check all instances. The proof at first created a considerable amount of discussion among mathematicians. But eventually, they accepted it. This led to what Tymoczko (1976) refers to as the new four-color problem, namely whether the acceptance implies a change in our conception of what a mathematical proof is. Previously, Tymoczko suggests, a proof was supposed to be convincing, surveyable, and formalizable. He acknowledges that the computer proof of 4CT is convincing and argues that it is in principle formalizable, but that it cannot be surveyable. He further notes that the computer adds an a posteriori element to the proof, as it depends on physical properties of the computer carrying it out. Both claims, the unsurveyability and the a posteriori nature of (our knowledge of) the proof, have been continuously debated in the ensuing years. See Mc Evoy (2024) for a comprehensive survey of the main points from these discussions.

During the 1990s experimental mathematics became a topic for discussion (Sørensen 2024). The journal Experimental Mathematics was established with its first issue appearing in 1992. Its aim is to publish papers that present not only results, but also the experimental processes that lead to them. In this sense, experiment is understood in a broad manner. However, other interpretations were proposed. In its most radical form, experimental mathematics envisions computers themselves as proving mathematical theorems and anticipates this to be the future of mathematics (Zeilberger 1993).

Slightly later, the use of automated theorem provers (ATPs), including but not limited to Isabelle/HOL, Coq, Lean, and Mizar, revitalized the interest in the formalization of mathematical proofs. The purpose of such proof assistants is to verify proofs by reformulating them into a suitable formal version that can be checked by one’s favorite theorem prover. A substantial portion of mathematical theorems have been incorporated into the libraries of these systems and important results with very long proofs—such as the Feit-Thompson odd-order theorem—have been verified (Avigad 2018, 685).

As of 2026, mathematics is using machine learning and LLMs to search for mathematical proofs or to help with other sorts of mathematical activities. According to the developers of LLMs such as Google, the prospect is highly promising: Whereas their 2024 model was able to perform at a level comparable to winning a silver medal at the International Mathematical Olympiad (IMO), their Gemini Deep Think was able to solve the problems given in 2025 according to gold-level standard. Mathematicians, however, are more cautious: Solving the problems of IMO is not sufficient to become a great mathematician (Riehl 2025).

Using language models (or deep neural networks) to solve (hard) mathematical problems is but one type of application of LLMs. Gastaldi (2024) presents an overview of the applications of language models in mathematics that distinguishes between four different types of purposes: acquiring mathematical skills, searching for proofs, object-manipulation, and supporting heuristics. Solving IMO problems is an instance of acquiring skills in which LLMs generally perform well if trained on a sufficiently large and wellchosen set of data.

When it comes to the generation of proofs, Gastaldi remarks that a hybrid strategy combining LLMs with ATPs is promising (2024, 3202). One approach is to use a language model to perform a backwards search from a given goal, proposing possible intermediate proof steps, and then relying on the ATP to verify the corresponding formal derivations.

Dean and Naibo (2025) are less optimistic about the prospects of AI systems generating mathematically interesting proofs. They maintain that there are principled reasons to expect that LLMs—whether used alone or in combination with proof assistants—are unlikely to produce proofs for certain types of theorems. Drawing on results from complexity and computational theory, they argue that computers are, in general, capable of solving only problems of low logical complexity: that is, problems expressible by formulas of the level of \( \Sigma _{1}^{0}\). To illustrate this point, they examine three well-known cases often mentioned as success stories in automated reasoning, including the Robbins’ problem (solved by McCune in 1997 using a SAT-solver) and the Boolean Pythagorean triple conjecture (solved by Heule, Kullmann, and Marek in 2016). They note that these problems all have low complexity. In contrast, as of 2026, many of the unsolved big problems in contemporary mathematics such as the Riemann hypothesis and \(P \neq NP\) are of higher complexity. Moreover, many historical problems that resisted solutions for centuries—such as the unsolvability of the classical problems and Fermat’s last theorem—were solved only after the introduction of new concepts, theories, and techniques. Interestingly, these were also components mentioned as problematic for SVPs.

In sum, the application of language models to mathematics raises several concerns for the philosopher of mathematical practice. As discussed, in 2026 ATPs and language models are influencing how mathematics is carried out and will continue to do so in the future. A major concern, shared by many mathematicians, is to explain what distinguishes the competencies or understanding of a research mathematician from the capacities of a computer (Avigad 2025; Riehl 2025). A second concern relates to the role of language in mathematics. Language models treat language only at the syntactic level, whereas previous work on the role of language in mathematics has focused largely on notations and representations—forms of language that crucially include semantic considerations.

3. Mathematical Explanations

One way to engage in mathematical practice is to examine mathematicians’ evaluative judgments about aspects of their practice. An important part of mathematical practice is formulating theorems and establishing that a proposed argument is in fact a rigorous proof. However, in addition to considerations about the correctness of theorems and rigorous proofs, mathematicians also value other properties of proofs, results, or theories, such as purity (Arana 2025); depth (Schiemer and Wigglesworth 2020); and aesthetic value (Inglis and Aberdein 2015; Giaquinto 2016).

Contributions that focus on mathematical explanations are presented in this section. When discussing this topic, philosophers distinguish between internal and external mathematical explanations. Internal explanations refer to cases where mathematics itself provides explanations of mathematical results. By contrast, the topic of external mathematical explanations is concerned with cases in which mathematics is invoked to explain phenomena outside of mathematics itself. This section begins with the topic of internal mathematical explanations.

Overviews: Pincock’s (2023) Mathematics and Explanation is a comprehensive introduction to the topic; for a shorter introduction, see Mancosu (2008b). The reader may also consult the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy entry by Mancosu, Poggiolesi, and Pincock (2025).

a. Explanatory Proofs

While explanations can take many forms, philosophers of mathematics have mainly focused on the topic of explanatory proofs. The underlying rationale is that mathematicians often seek not only to establish that a particular result is true, but also to understand why it holds. The idea that proofs possess epistemic virtues beyond merely establishing truth has been noted by mathematicians throughout history. The distinction between proofs that merely demonstrate that a proposition is true—and those that explain why it is true—can be traced back to Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics, where explanatory understanding is tied to knowledge of causes and the essence of the subject matter (Mancosu et al. 2025).

In what follows, a few key contributions to the study of explanatory proofs are considered; however, note that both historical and contemporary mathematicians appeal to explanation more broadly. Examples include the claim that fruitful generalizations are precisely the ones that are explanatory (Hafner and Mancosu 2005) and explaining a puzzling result by demonstrating how it is an instance of a more abstract theory (J. Carter). Beginning with Mancosu (2001), several philosophers of mathematical practice have drawn attention to these broader roles of explanation (Lange 2018; D’Alessandro 2020; Pincock 2023).

One approach begins with examples of proofs that are widely regarded as explanatory, accompanied by an analysis of what makes them so. This method is exemplified in the work of Steiner (1978). In this seminal paper, Steiner proposes that a proof is explanatory if it appeals to a characterizing property of an entity mentioned in the theorem—a property that uniquely identifies the entity within a relevant domain. A simple example would be a theorem about even numbers where the corresponding proof relies on the fact that any even number is divisible by two. Moreover, the proof must make clear how the truth of the theorem depends on this particular property. Note how this criterion allows for a case-by-case assessment of whether a given proof is explanatory.

In contrast, Kitcher (1981) offers a global and comparative account of explanation. On his view, the central notion is unification: A theory is more explanatory to the extent that it reduces the number of independent facts we must accept. Kitcher formalizes this idea in terms of argument patterns, suggesting that the most explanatory theory is the one that can derive many results using a small number of recurring inferential patterns. A helpful illustration is the development of modern calculus, which introduced systematic rules for computing derivatives and integrals—replacing the creative and often ad hoc methods used prior to the mid-17th century.

Both Steiner’s and Kitcher’s accounts have been critically examined by philosophers of mathematical practice. A common strategy in these discussions is to present a proof—either considered explanatory or non-explanatory—and assess whether it satisfies the proposed criterion. This approach is exemplified in the work of Hafner and Mancosu (2005, 2008) and Tappenden (2005), who analyze a wide range of case studies, including a convergence criterion for sequences, Euclidean plane geometry (as formulated by Euclid versus Hilbert’s Foundations of Geometry), and real algebraic geometry.

Hafner and Mancosu (2008), for instance, describe how results can be obtained in real algebraic geometry. They show, more specifically, that theorems formulated in the elementary language of real algebraic geometry may be established by proofs that first show that the theorem is true in a certain structure, say the real numbers. Such proofs may use properties specific to the real numbers and hence not shared by all real closed fields. Nevertheless, because of a transfer theorem valid for this theory, one can conclude that the statement is true in all real closed fields. Despite the formal power of such methods, they find that these proofs are not regarded as explanatory by the mathematical community. A similar phenomenon is observed in projective geometry, where the notion of dual propositions allows for the derivation of one theorem from another by interchanging terms—yet these derivations are likewise not typically seen as explanatory (Tappenden 2005). Both examples challenge Kitcher’s claim that a theory that merely reduces the number of argument patterns should be considered as explanatory.

In view of the shortcomings of both Steiner’s and Kitcher’s original characterizations, scholars have formulated other positions or suggested modifications to them. Lange (2017) has developed an account based on a shift of focus from characterizing properties to salient features of mathematical results—such as unexpected symmetries, patterns, or structural relationships—that are illuminated by the proof. On Lange’s view, a proof is explanatory when it reveals how these striking features arise from the mathematical properties of the entities involved in the theorem. Rather than identifying a unique property that singles out an entity, Lange emphasizes the explanatory role of showing how the result fits into a broader mathematical structure or pattern.

Other accounts draw inspiration from discussions of explanation in the philosophy of science. Frans and Weber (2014) suggest that mechanisms may provide the key to characterizing mathematical explanation, adapting a proposal originally developed in the philosophy of biology. Another line of work takes inspiration from contextual approaches, according to which what counts as an explanation depends on the context of the proof. This direction has been pursued by Delarivière, Frans, and Van Kerkhove (2017). See Mancosu et al. (2025) for an elaboration of these accounts and further approaches.

b. External Explanations

The discussion of external mathematical explanations is closely tied to debates about the ontology of mathematics, particularly through a reformulation of the indispensability argument. In its original form, formulated by Quine and Putnam, the indispensability argument asserts that mathematics is indispensable to our best scientific theories and thus we should be committed to the existence of the entities that the mathematical theory quantifies over (Panza and Sereni 2013, chaps. 6-7). The so-called “Enhanced Indispensability Argument” goes further, claiming that in certain cases mathematics plays an indispensable explanatory role in science, and that only in such cases should we be committed to the existence of the entities that the mathematical theory quantifies over. This line of inquiry has led to a closer analysis of actual cases of mathematical applications in science with the aim of determining whether the mathematics plays an explanatory role or only a descriptive role. While the list of examples is extensive, a few illustrative cases are mentioned.

One of the discussed examples of an external mathematical explanation involves the life cycles of periodical cicadas. Certain species of cicadas emerge every 13 or 17 years—both prime numbers. In addition to biological explanations, Baker (2005) argues that the fact that the prime number life cycles minimize intersections with predator life cycles is a mathematical explanation. According to Baker, the explanatory power lies in the mathematical property of primeness, which reduces the frequency of overlap with predators that have shorter periodic life cycles.

Baker’s proposal has generated several responses. Scholars such as Lange and Colyvan defend the view that mathematics can provide genuine and non-redundant explanations of physical phenomena. In contrast, critics such as Saatsi and Pincock question whether mathematics in such cases plays an indispensable explanatory role, or whether it merely tracks underlying causal structures. Further examples discussed include the application of graph theory to solve the problem of the bridges of Königsberg (Pincock 2023) and applications of mathematics in physics such as phase spaces (Lyon and Colyvan 2008). See Pincock (2023, sec. 5) for an elaboration of this debate and references. Bueno and French (2018) offer a nuanced account along with a range of illustrative examples from physics that highlight the complexity of assessing explanatory indispensability.

These discussions raise fundamental philosophical questions, such as: “What counts as an explanation?” and “What is the precise relationship between mathematical theories or concepts and the empirical phenomena they are used to explain?”

c. Mathematical Understanding

A related area is mathematical understanding. On some accounts, understanding is taken to be closely tied with or even dependent on explanation, as exemplified by the work of Inglis and MejíaRamos (2021) and others. Inglis and MejíaRamos draw on the notion of functional explanation, characterizing explanations as the kinds of things that generate understanding. Using this characterization in combination with a cognitive model, they argue that it is possible to derive the aforementioned accounts offered by Steiner, Kitcher, and Lange.

As of 2026, several contributions treat understanding as a distinct phenomenon, grounded in how mathematicians conceptualize mathematical ideas, approach complex problems, and rely on mathematical representations. While not all these accounts are directly inspired by Thurston’s “On Proof and Progress in Mathematics,” many share his view of mathematical understanding as describing how people understand and think about mathematics (1994, 162).

Understanding, in this sense, is associated with features such as fruitfulness and visualization (Tappenden 2005) and modularizing—the ability to break down complex reasoning into manageable parts (Avigad 2020). The latter is further articulated by Kenneth Manders in combination with recasting and “irresponsiveness,” in his widely circulated but unpublished manuscript “Expressive Means and Intellectual Virtue in Mathematics.” Importantly, this perspective shifts the focus away from understanding as a relation between an individual and a piece of mathematical content. The agent is typically conceived as a mathematical community and understanding may depend on available conceptual resources. Other accounts further take into consideration general cognitive and perceptual constraints—for example, the limited capacity of human attention—which shape our mathematical activities.

One frequently noted aspect of human attention is the observation that visual representations can contribute to mathematical understanding. A commonly discussed example is the formula \(1+2+ \ldots n=\frac{n(n+1)}{2}\), together with visual arguments based on triangular arrangements of dots or squares as shown in Figure 1. Although the formula has a rigorous proof by induction, such a proof provides little insight into why the expression has this form. By contrast, this is more evident from the visual argument.

Math-Practice-Figure 1

Figure 1. A visual representation of the sum of the first n (or 5) numbers. Compute the area of the rectangle and divide it by 2 to obtain the result: \(\frac{n\left(n+1\right)}{2}\).

Despite the fact that visual representations can contribute to our understanding, most scholars argue that visualization is not the primary reason for understanding and therefore explain how it is reducible to other, more fundamental notions such as Steiner’s characterizing property. An exception is Tappenden (2005), who argues that understanding is tied both to the capacity to generate new results and to visualization, claiming that fruitful formulations of a problem are precisely those that can be visualized. In the next and final section, the role of visual representations in mathematical practice is discussed.

4. Visual Thinking in Mathematics

In the philosophy of mathematics visual thinking refers to the use of visual representations in mathematics. One distinguishes between external representations, such as drawn diagrams, and internal representations which include mental models. Philosophers of mathematical practice typically note that various visual representations are used—historically as well as in contemporary mathematical practice—and seek to explain the roles they play. The preceding section, “Mathematical Reasoning and Proof,” discusses the role of diagrams in contemporary mathematical proofs. This section presents some aspects of the historical use of diagrams and some considerations about their heuristic role.

Monograph and overviews: Giaquinto’s Visual Thinking in Mathematics (2007) is the first general monograph on this topic covering a broad range of themes. Giaquinto defends, among other things, a Kantian inspired epistemology of diagrams and argues that in certain cases diagrams play a non-redundant role in proofs. Crucially, he also demonstrates how arithmetic calculations and symbolic reasoning depend on different aspects of visual thinking. Giaquinto is also the author of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy entry on the “Epistemology of Visual Thinking” (2015). In addition, there are two overviews written by Giardino: “Diagrammatic Reasoning in Mathematics” (2017b) and “Diagrammatic Proofs in Mathematics: (Almost) 20 Years of Research” (2024). Waszek’s “Sign as a Theme in the Philosophy of Mathematical Practice” (2024) reviews contributions that deal with the role of signs in mathematics, treating diagrams as a special instance.

a. Diagrams in the History of Mathematics

Visual representations—and more broadly signs of various forms—are extensively used in contemporary mathematical practice. Historically, diagrams also played an important role. This is particularly true of the mathematics of the ancient Greeks as documented by Netz (1999). Based on a detailed analysis of available texts, Netz (chap. 2) suggests that diagrams are metonyms for their propositions in the mathematics of the Greeks: Each proposition is accompanied by a unique diagram, and in certain cases the diagram is needed to fix the reference of geometric points mentioned in the text. Moreover, information used in demonstrations is read off from diagrams. The last observation is also made by Manders in his seminal “The Euclidean Diagram” (2008), circulated as early as 1995. This article offers a rational reconstruction of ancient Greek mathematical practice, explaining the success of Euclidean plane geometry as presented in the first six books of Euclid’s Elements. An important part of Manders’ account is an analysis of what information is read off from diagrams. This has resulted in an influential distinction between co-exact versus exact attributes of a diagram. A co-exact attribute is a property that is not changed by continuous deformations of the diagram. Examples include the crossing of the two drawn circles of the often-discussed proposition I.1—demonstrating how to construct an equilateral triangle on a given line segment—and that a figure is contained in another. The latter occurs, among other places, in proposition II.11 that shows how to cut a line segment in two parts, corresponding to the golden ratio. Following Figure 2, the proposition shows how to cut the line AB in H so that the square on AH is equal to the rectangle formed by HB and AB. During the demonstration it is shown that rectangle FI is equal to the square on AB. The diagram yields the information that rectangle AI is part of both figures. Using Common Notion 3, “if equals are subtracted from equals, then the remainders are equal,” one may remove this from the aforementioned identity to get the result.

An example of an exact attribute is the equality of two line-segments. The demonstration of II.11 exploits that AB is equal to BC, but this follows from the previous construction of the square on AB, that is, this piece of information is inferred from the text. Manders establishes that only co-exact properties are read off from diagrams in the plane geometry of the Elements.

Math-Practice-Figure 2

Figure 2. The diagram accompanying Elements II.11: To cut a line so that the square on one part is identical to the rectangle formed by the other part and the whole line segment. In other words, the square on AH is equal to rectangle HC.

Since information is read off from diagrams, a concern is how to formally justify the diagram-based demonstrations of the Elements. An important contribution towards this end is Mumma’s (2010, 2019) system, Eu. Inspired by Manders’ reconstruction, this system is a diagram-based formal axiomatic system that is a faithful representation of the Elements.

The Elements has had an enormous impact. Both the logical structure of the books and the geometric content have influenced mathematicians long after it was written. The structure of the books, beginning with definitions of the basic geometrical concepts and axioms (referred to as postulates and common notions) before formulating propositions and their demonstrations, has played a significant role as an ideal of mathematical presentation in mathematical texts. The meaning of the terms definition and axiom, however, has changed and been up for debate since the time of Euclid. Axiom, according to some interpretations, may refer to a self-evident truth whereas Euclid may have considered the postulates as what must be assumed in order to do plane geometry. See Schlimm (2013) and Cantù (2023) for discussions about different interpretations of axiom. One of the most famous exchanges on definitions and the nature of axioms in axiomatic systems is the correspondence between Hilbert and Frege after the publication of Hilbert’s Grundlagen der Geometrie in 1899 (Frege 1984).

Since Euclid’s Elements, geometry, together with its diagram-based proofs, was considered the foundation in many areas of mathematics until at least around the early 18th century. Around the turn of the 20th century, however, many prominent scholars, such as Moritz Pasch, David Hilbert, Hans Hahn and Bertrand Russell rejected proofs that refer to diagrams, pointing out that figures are not reliable and that geometric intuition cannot be trusted. Typically, examples from analysis or plane geometry are presented as evidence of this unreliability, such as Weierstrass’ construction of a curve that is everywhere continuous but nowhere differentiable. The reasons for the disappearance of diagrams in geometry more generally are less clear. Lorenat’s “Figures real, imagined, and missing in Poncelet, Plücker, and Gergonne” (2015) provides some insight into the role and gradual disappearance of figures (as they were referred to by the mathematicians in question) in early 19th century projective geometry.

Concerning the role of diagrams, Hilbert expressed the following in some of his unpublished lectures at the end of the 19th century: “A theorem is only proved when the proof is completely independent of the diagram. The proof must call step by step on the preceding axioms” (Mancosu 2005, 14). Around the same time, Russell exclaimed that “in the best books there are no figures at all” (1901, 99).

On the other hand, there is Larkin and Simon’s famous “Why a Diagram Is (Sometimes) Worth 10,000 Words” (1987) which suggests that diagrams are valued in contexts other than proofs. Indeed, in an often-quoted passage, Pasch writes that a figure “does facilitate essentially the grasp of the relations stated in the theorem and the constructions applied in the proof. Moreover, it is a fruitful tool to discover such relationships and constructions” (Mancosu 2005, 14, citing Pasch, Moritz. 1882/1926. Vorlesungen uber neuere Geometrie 1st ed. B.G. Teuber; 2nd ed. J. Springer). That is, diagrams may be valued because of heuristic purposes such as contributing to our understanding (as mentioned in the previous section) and as tools for discovering new mathematics.

In the remainder of this section, two issues and related questions that these observations give rise to are presented. Note that studies on visual thinking in mathematics are largely inspired by both historical work and analyses of current mathematical practice. The first issue concerns the observation that the use of, or reference to, diagrams in mathematical demonstrations is not exclusive to Greek mathematics. The second issue involves studies on the heuristic role of visual representations in contemporary mathematical practice that began in the 21st century.

Diagrammatic representations were used extensively in early cultures other than that of the ancient Greeks, as documented by scholars such as Chemla and Høyrup; see Mancosu et al. (2005). Crucially, these diagrams served as demonstrations of the correctness of algorithms long before the Greeks allegedly introduced the notion of a mathematical proof. For example, although the original figures have not survived, Høyrup argues that the Babylonian solutions to what in contemporary terms are quadratic equations were nevertheless accompanied by drawn geometric figures demonstrating the correctness of the given algorithms.

Moreover, the use of diagrams varies across different cultures and periods. Describing how they functioned is not only of interest to historians of mathematics as they can serve as inspiration when analyzing the various roles of diagrams in contemporary contexts. Chemla’s “The Proof Is in the Diagram: Liu Yi and the Graphical Writing of Algebraic Equations in Eleventh-Century China” (2018) offers an insightful and detailed analysis of a distinctive diagram found in a text written in the 13th century by Yang Hui. The diagram in question appears there as part of a quotation from a text by Liu Yi written in the 11th century.

The diagram itself has the shape of a rectangle; it is divided into smaller rectangles and some of these contain inscriptions in the form of text and numbers. See Figure 3 for a simplified version. On one reading, the diagram is a representation of the mathematical problem given a particular quadratic equation (formulated in words) to determine its solution. Importantly, Chemla argues that the diagram is more; it should also be interpreted as the statement of a proof of the correctness of the algorithm designed to solve it (2018, 63). This claim rests on a puzzling feature of the diagram—the coloring of one of its rectangular parts. It turns out that the colored rectangle holds the key to understanding how one of the operations mentioned in the algorithm corresponds to the rectangles that constitute the diagram. The operation does not directly correspond to what is observed in the static diagram; rather, the colored piece functions as a tool telling the reader how to rearrange the rectangles to obtain the result. Note finally that the diagram requires a dynamic interpretation. It is meant to be read in correspondence with—and thereby to warrant—the steps of the written algorithm.

Math-Practice-Figure 3

Figure 3. The diagram represents the problem reformulated using contemporary terminology: “The area of the rectangular figure is 864 bu and the sum of its length and width is 60 bu. What is the width? The solution is 24 bu.” Rectangles in the original diagram contain text corresponding to steps of the solution algorithm. The colored piece at the bottom holds the key to understanding the algorithm given to solve the problem.

b. The Effectiveness of Diagrams

The last issue to be considered is the attempt to understand why visual representations are effective tools in mathematics.

One line of research treats diagrams as cognitive tools, drawing on results from cognitive science to explain their use in mathematics. Giardino has shown that diagrams can enhance mathematical reasoning in a variety of ways. Cognitive tools are designed to reduce cognitive load, and in mathematics they appear in different forms, ranging from computational devices to drawn diagrams. Moreover, the cognitive tools used in mathematics can often be manipulated—either physically or in one’s imagination—according to explicit rules that correspond to operations defined on the represented situation. A related concept is that of manipulative imagination, introduced by De Toffoli and Giardino to describe how reasoning proceeds in lowdimensional topology. Further analyzing this ability, Giardino (2018) explains how it draws on a combination of our cognitive capacities and our experience with manipulating physical objects.

A second line of research investigates the ways in which diagrams facilitate mathematical discovery. Carter (2010) discusses an example in which a diagrammatic representation of permutations led to a distinction between crossing and noncrossing permutations, as well as to a proof sketch for a relation between noncrossing permutations and another combinatorial property. Allegedly, the visual representations of planar algebras employed by Fields Medalist Vaughan Jones enabled results that could not have been obtained from formal presentations alone. Similar observations are made in studies such as Starikova (2010). These cases raise questions: “Why do visual representations sometimes lead to new mathematical results? Do they possess properties that other forms of representation lack—properties that might help explain their fruitfulness?”

Responding to these questions requires a different methodology than analyzing visual representations case-by-case. One approach is to borrow tools or concepts from other fields and investigate whether they—perhaps with suitable modification—can help identify properties characteristic of fruitful representations. A particularly relevant field is semiotics, with its study of the properties and functions of signs. Because of its richness and close connections to mathematics, the theory of semiotics developed by Charles Sanders Peirce is especially interesting. Among Peirce’s signs, the icon—a sign that represents its object by virtue of sharing certain likenesses with it—seems particularly promising:

The reasoning of mathematicians will be found to turn chiefly upon the use of likenesses, which are the very hinges of the gates of their science. The utility of the likenesses to mathematicians consists in their suggesting in a very precise way, new aspects of the states of things (1998, 6).

Note that although mathematical icons need not take the form of diagrams, they may still hold the key to characterizing properties of fruitful representations (Carter 2017).

Another interesting concept is that of a “free ride.” Shimojima (2001) argues that free rides are characterizing properties of graphic representations (in contrast to linguistic representations) and has introduced a formal framework to analyze how they relate to other properties of such representations. Informally, a free ride is a consequential piece of information that can be read off from a representation whenever this information has not been intentionally added when constructing it. An example of a free ride occurs when constructing a Venn diagram as a representation of a syllogism: After representing the two premises, the conclusion can be read off from the diagram. Carter (2021) uses the components of this framework to analyze four different mathematical examples where something like free rides occur. The cases include Riemann’s visual representation of the condition to be a complex function which gave rise to the notion of a conformal mapping, a construction of a commutative diagram in category theory that demonstrates that a relation is transitive, and calculations of invariants made easier by representing C*-algebras by directed graphs. The conclusion is that sometimes mathematical free rides conform to Shimojima’s description, but in other cases they do not. Moreover, Carter finds that other typical features of diagrams explain their capacity to reveal new information, for example, that they form two-dimensional displays and allow for controlled multiple readings.

The last note concerns the use of terminology. The term “diagram” is often used broadly to refer to all kinds of two-dimensional displays or figures. However, when analyzing properties of visual representations, it is useful to be more precise. Not everything that is two-dimensional is necessarily a diagram—but how should the distinction be drawn? For example, are the graph of a function, a lattice, a geometric figure, a table, a matrix, or a picture of a manifold all diagrams? Moreover, diagrams or graphic representations are normally contrasted with other types of representations such as linguistic or sentential ones. In addition to these, there are mathematical notations: the symbols used to write expressions, many of which are deliberately arranged in twodimensional layouts. How should these be classified? Some suggestions can be found in De Toffoli (2022) and Carter (2024, sec. 3.3.1).

5. Conclusion

Taken together, the three presented topics—mathematical reasoning and proofs, mathematical explanations, and visual thinking in mathematics—illustrate the breadth of contemporary work in PMP. They exemplify how PMP expands the range of issues traditionally considered in the philosophy of mathematics. This conclusion summarizes how the different features of PMP identified in the introduction are reflected in these topics.

Throughout the article, a variety of specific questions addressed in PMP studies are mentioned; for example, how to characterize explanatory proofs as instances of epistemic virtues or how to identify characterizing properties of fruitful representations. Moreover, responding to these questions involves examining a range of diverse mathematical theories, such as cluster algebras, topology, real algebraic geometry, and Euclidean plane geometry.

Studies of mathematical practice often treat mathematics as a human activity rather than a static body of results. This perspective is reflected in accounts of proofs that tell agents what to do—such as the recipe model of proof—in contrast to viewing proofs simply as sequences of formal statements. In the discussion of visual thinking, it was similarly noted that certain diagrams invite a dynamic mode of reading. More generally, work in this area emphasizes how we operate on signs in mathematical practice and how these signs can inspire mathematical development.

In addition to viewing mathematics as an activity, one may also regard it as an inherently human activity—one in which human abilities influence how mathematics is carried out. This perspective is reflected in discussions of the role of proofs when emphasizing that they should not only be rigorous, but also understandable by human beings and capable of generating new ideas. In the context of visual thinking, it was noted that the form in which information is presented can affect what is possible to do with it.

As emphasized, PMP often draws on other domains such as the history of mathematics and cognitive science. As illustrated here, work on proof, explanations, and diagrams is frequently inspired by detailed historical studies of their use. Moreover, contributions discussing the role of signs more broadly refer to results drawn from cognitive science. Finally, it has been noted, often in passing, how studies integrate empirical findings into their work. One example is the survey of the frequency of imperative verbs appearing in mathematical proofs, which has been used to support the recipe model of proof.

6. References and Further Reading

References are provided for readers interested in further study; the overviews and collections listed in the article present a variety of perspectives on PMP, some of which are not included within the article.

Readers interested in a broader view of PMP that includes historical practices are referred to the four-volume collection Handbook of the History and Philosophy of Mathematical Practice (Sriraman 2024).

Overviews of PMP include Mancosu, Jørgensen, and Pedersen (2005); Mancosu (2008a); Van Bendegem (2014); Giardino (2017a); Carter (2019, 2024); and De Toffoli and Mancosu (2026). The introduction to Ferreirós and Gray (2006) is a historically oriented presentation of the field. The following collections contain a large number of articles within PMP: Van Kerkhove and Van Bendegem (2007); Mancosu (2008); Van Kerkhove (2009); Van Kerkhove, De Vuyst, and Van Bendegem (2010); and Sriraman (2024).

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Author Information

Jessica Carter
Email: jessica@css.au.dk
Aarhus University
Denmark

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy