Albert Borgmann (1937-2023)

Albert Borgmann was an American philosopher who worked in the Continental tradition on two primary questions relating to modern technology and how we can live a good life within a technological age. While primarily hailed as representative of the American strain of philosophy of technology that came to fruition in the late 1970s, this classification fails to do justice to Borgmann’s vast portfolio. His seminal book Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life (1984) has received the most attention, with much less paid to his later work, which concerned such myriad topics as philosophy of design and architecture, Christian theology, semiotics, and virtue ethics. To this end, Borgmann considered himself a philosopher of society and culture, and primarily focused on technology because he believed it to be the defining characteristic of our current society and culture.

For Borgmann, the best way to understand modern technology was to see it as a pattern that constrains and encourages certain kinds of actions, inaction and attitudes. The term he gave to this pattern of modern technological objects was that of the “device paradigm,” a “device” being a technical (modern) object which delivers a product or service in a way that is concealed from the user, meaning that it requires minimal effort, engagement or skill. For example, whereas once people had to learn to build a fire and keep it burning in order to heat their homes, now one simply turns on the thermostat to achieve the same result. In this case, the thermostat is a device that produces the commodity of heat on demand. While we may appreciate having electrically heated homes, the ease and simplicity of devices comes at a cost. Devices naturally come to displace and eradicate what Borgmann terms “focal things” and “focal practices.” Focal things and focal practices require attention, engagement and skill that evoke care and continuity with the world. According to Borgmann, the central concern with the device paradigm is that its expansion has meant that previously focal things and practices have progressively become converted into devices, lessening our engagement with the world. In this sense, Borgmann is unique in diagnosing the problems of technology in relational terms—the way in which technology adversely impacts human relationships as well as our relationship with objects and our environment. Therefore, a world that is patterned by the ubiquity of devices is one that raises unique social, political and moral concerns, and these concerns call for particular investigation as part and parcel of technological life. It is these related issues that occupy much of Borgmann’s later work.

Life and Works
Philosophy of Technology
Ethics and Technology
Critical Reception and Influence
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works

Despite being described as the “the most American of all the American philosophers of technology” (Tijmes 1997), Albert Borgmann was born in Freiburg, Germany in 1937, and initially came to the United States in 1958 for a semester at the University of Texas. After completing his PhD at the University of Munich in 1964, he returned to the United States and briefly taught German Literature at the University of Illinois before finding philosophy positions at DePaul University (1965) and the University of Hawaii (1967). In 1970 he joined the philosophy department at the University of Montana, Missoula. He would remain at Montana for five decades until his retirement in 2020. He passed away three years later on May 7, 2023.

Albert Borgmann’s early work was strongly influenced by Martin Heidegger. While not directly a student of Heidegger, Borgmann’s PhD supervisor at the University of Munich—Max Müeller—had been one of Heidegger’s Catholic followers. Accordingly, in the mid ’60s Borgmann began his philosophical career by publishing a handful of essays on Heidegger, including “Language in Heidegger’s Philosophy” (1966), “The Transformation of Heidegger’s Thought” (1966), and “Philosophy and the Concern for Man” (1966). These “studious and clumsy” articles—as Borgmann later described in an autobiographical essay—gave him the chance to “gather his thoughts” until his first essay of significance, “Technology and Reality” (1971). For this reason, Borgmann considered Heidegger’s philosophy of technology to be the most important dimension of Heidegger’s work, and credits Heidegger with showing him “the problem that needed attention” (Borgmann 1993). It should then come as no surprise that many of Borgmann’s commentators have described him as “neo-Heideggerian,” a “clear heir to the German thinker,” and the “foremost Heideggerian philosopher of technology” (See Hickman 1992).

Borgmann wrote over one-hundred articles and a total seven books, the last of which was published posthumously in 2023:

Philosophy of Language: Historical Foundations and Contemporary Issues (1974)

A revised version of Borgmann’s doctoral dissertation on the history of the philosophy of language. This book is relatively distinct from his mature work, and he would later refer to it as having deservedly “fallen deadborn from the press” (Borgmann 1993).

Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life (1984)

The most well known of Borgmann’s books and a staple text in the philosophy of technology. Here, Borgmann outlines his theory of technology, the device paradigm and the distinction between focal things and devices.

Crossing the Postmodern Divide (1992)

This book provides an overview of contemporary technological culture and its historical evolution. Borgmann maps the intellectual origins of the modern period and the resulting cultural transition that culminates in postmodernism. He is especially concerned with a variant of postmodernism, which he describes as “hypermodernism,” a consumerist culture that increasingly values the artificial over the real. Instead, he urges “focal realism,” an emphasis on the tangible, focal experiences that centre our lives and provide meaning and focus.

Holding on to Reality: The Nature of Information at the Turn of the Millennium (1999)

In this book Borgmann draws on the history of information and considers the relationship between things and signs, and between reality and information.

Power Failure: Christianity in the Culture of Technology (2003)

By drawing attention to the widespread loss of purpose, community and value in contemporary technological society, Borgmann argues that Christianity is the most promising response to technology and consumer culture.

Real American Ethics: Taking Responsibility for Our Country (2006)

Here Borgmann outlines his theory of “real ethics,” that ethical theory should take seriously the design and architecture of our material environments. The physical setting of our lives—the way we choose to build, inhabit and engage with our space—has profound moral implications for the kind and quality of lives we live.

Moral Cosmology: On Being in the World Fully and Well (2024)

Published posthumously, Moral Cosmology represents a final return to a fundamental question that occupied Borgmann throughout his career: what constitutes the good life in a technological society? Here, Borgmann points to the loss of holistic and comprehensive historical worldviews, “moral cosmologies” and attempts to reconcile this loss with the rise of modern science.

2. Philosophy of Technology

Borgmann does not consider technology as an ensemble of machines and procedures, but rather a “type of culture.” For this reason, Borgmann defines technology as the “characteristic way in which contemporary man takes up with reality” (Borgmann 1984, 35). In other words, modern technology represents a way of living in and experiencing the world.

Working within the philosophy of technology, Borgmann seeks to understand the gains and losses that have taken place as a result of technological phenomenon and processes—those he terms “devices.” A device is a (technological) object that delivers a result in a way that is concealed from the user—without effort or engagement—and is impervious to context. Devices, therefore, are numerous in shape and form, and include such archetypical objects as television and fast food, but also infrastructure, such as high-rise buildings, or procedures such as cosmetic surgery. In this sense, devices are ubiquitous throughout our contemporary world, and when taken together, come to characterize modern life. This is problematic to the extent that devices have a tendency to disrupt and displace those things and practices—focal things and focal practices—that centre our lives and provide meaningful engagement with others and the world around us. Accordingly, our lives become impoverished and superficial, and our actions and motivations impeded and constrained.

This technologically informed way of living, however, is not random but widespread and repetitive, forming what we can recognize as a pattern. For this reason, Borgmann distinguishes his understanding of technology as a pattern or a “paradigm” from other philosophical theories of technology, namely technological determinism and technological instrumentalism.

Technological determinists see technology as a force in its own right—for good or bad—and one that increasingly determines human behaviour and the trajectory of human society towards increased technological entrenchment. While Borgmann believes determinism is useful as a bold and comprehensive critique of technology, he explicitly rejects it throughout his work. Unlike determinists, Borgmann sees the possibility for reforming technology in both our individual and collective lives, and this requires room for meaningful choice and agency (Borgmann 1984, 10-11). Individually, we must learn to use technology discerningly, and do so in a way that moves technology away from the centre of our lives and into the proverbial background in favour of fostering focality.

However, Borgmann also rejects technological instrumentalism, the view that technology is a value-neutral tool and therefore assumes that technology (and its consequences) can be fixed, if only we can determine what we should be developing and using technology for. Borgmann agrees that this instrumental analysis is “unassailable” given that it is true that any specific example of technology can be used as a tool for whatever we choose. Turning on the television to stay up to date on the progress of a hurricane is an unobjectionable use in comparison with binging reality shows. Nonetheless, instrumentalism is a “short-sighted” or superficial view, given that instrumentalism underestimates the role technology plays and ignores the definitive and “deeply entrenched” way of taking up with the world that modern technology engenders (Borgmann 1984, 163). In this sense, a “case-by-case appraisal” of distinct technologies and their uses is ultimately “inconclusive” in understanding the impact of technology on our lives as a whole. It is for this reason that Borgmann’s device paradigm is conceived of as a pattern which helps us to look beyond the situational to take the “measure of technological life in its normal totality” (Borgmann 1984, 208).

Importantly, for Borgmann, “technology” implies something that is uniquely modern, having begun with the Industrial Revolution and modern science. Therefore, modern technology is not simply an extension of human tool making and tool using—which has existed throughout the history of our species—but constitutes a ground-breaking change of the human condition. This is due, in part, to the way technology evolved as part and parcel with the Enlightenment, and therefore embodies a historically contingent promise of liberation and freedom. Technology aims to provide material liberty in the form of comfort and conveniences, and ultimately what Borgmann describes as “ontological liberty,” the liberty from the burdens of reality. However, there are good and bad burdens. A bad burden is dying of cholera; a good burden is the effort of preparing and sharing a meal with friends and family. Medical developments, protection from heat and cold, improvements in sanitation and safety, these are all so-called “defensive products” that intervene between us and our circumstances, and in most cases Borgmann agrees that they are undeniably beneficial.

For this reason, Borgmann distinguishes between the “constructive phase” of technology (roughly ~1850-1950) where it succeeded in providing these fundamentals of life, and its current “degenerative” or “commodious” phase, where its aims become increasingly “frivolous” and “dubious” (Borgmann 2003, 122). The success of technology in living up to its inherent promise of liberation is therefore ambivalent, given that it begins with solving real and urgent problems— such as providing clean water—and then devolves into providing what is more convenient or comfortable, such as flavoured water in portable plastic bottles (Borgmann 2008a, 8). This leads to an ironic side or “ironical turn” to the promise of technology, where technological development has not lived up to its aspirations (Borgmann 1984, 39). One of Borgmann’s projects, therefore, is to evaluate our culture’s achievements against what appear to be its own inherent ideas and possibilities.

For this reason, Borgmann does not argue for the removal of the device paradigm entirely—if that were even possible—but insists that we must prune it back so that its actual promise can be realized. Using this as a metric, technological culture falls short, as instead of providing us with better opportunities to pursue genuine “wealth” in the form of focality and festivity, it has instead constrained and displaced it through “affluence,” the ubiquity of devices and the consumption of commodities. Therefore, the possibilities modern technology have opened to us are what make it unique, and yet at the same time, these very possibilities lay fallow.

a. Devices and Commodification

Devices are (technological) tools, objects or phenomenon that function to disburden the user. This disburdenment takes place through concealment, where the machinery of the device makes limited demands on our skill, strength and attention and subsequently “shrinks” from our view.

Borgmann does not limit devices to simply the stereotypical mechanical examples, such as a light switch or a car. Rather, “whatever is truly available is a device,” meaning that whatever object, phenomenon or process demonstrates the characteristics of availability can be understood as a device or having the quality of deviceness. The characteristics of availability include ubiquity, efficiency, safety and ease of use, and the more these characteristics are maximized in any given device, the more readily available the commodity produced becomes. For example, a microwave makes heated food readily available to us without the effort of having to build a fire or even wait for the oven to heat up. So too, a television makes available the commodity of entertainment. Historically, televisions were expensive with poor audio and visual quality. Yet they developed to make entertainment commodities more available by way of better quality, affordability and increased ubiquity—you can now watch television on almost any digital device. All devices, then, ultimately serve to procure greater availability. This availability subsequently impacts our relationship and engagement with the world and each other. As succinctly described by Borgmann:

Devices [dissolve] the coherent and engaging character of the pre-technological world of things. In a device, the relatedness of the world is replaced by a machinery, but the machinery is concealed, and the commodities which are made available by a device are enjoyed without the encumbrance of or the engagement with a context (Borgmann 1984, 47).

A commodity is subsequently “what a device is there for,” that is to say, what a device makes available to us. Borgmann’s conception of commodities and commodification is therefore necessary to answering the assumption that modern technology simply represents a more efficient and effective way of doing what has always been done. The radical novelty of the device paradigm rests in the distinction and subsequent dislocation between ends and means. The means to procuring the commodity (the device) are changeable and often variable—they develop in accordance with innovation—while the commodity, what is procured, is relatively stable. Therefore, every device has a “functional equivalent,” an equivalent device that may be physically or structurally dissimilar but in one way or another, achieves the same or a similar result. In this sense, the machinery of a device can be changed “radically” without a threat to the “function and identity” of the device.

A clear example can be seen in Borgmann’s comparison between a mechanical watch and a digital watch. Both serve to procure the commodity of information, albeit, the digital or smartwatch procures infinitely more available information (the weather, text messages, heart rate and so forth). In this sense, the function of a watch is stable and clairvoyant, and we recognize both watches as serving one of the same function. Yet, the way this information is produced—the machinery and process—is radically different. A spring and wheel powers one of them and a microcomputer chip and LED screen powers the other. A mechanical watch and a digital or smartwatch are functional equivalents but represent a drastic difference in how the end result is produced. Therefore, this radical variability of means in contrast to the relative stability of ends is a defining feature of modern technology. In this sense we can see how Borgmann’s conception of devices was partially inspired by functionalism, the theory that phenomenon can be identified by their functional role regardless of variable manifestations (see, for example, functionalism in philosophy of mind).

Another defining feature of devices is that of the concealment of means coupled with prominence of ends. While there have always been tools, institutions and instruments to disburden people from effort, skill and attention, these institutions and instruments functioned without concealment. A good example of this—and one that Borgmann frequently refers to—is eating. Eating once demanded intricate and collective participation, including planting, harvesting, hunting, slaughter, salting, preparing, and this process was intelligible to most people. To this end, eating was continuous with a long process that extended from seed to table, and connected people with each other, tradition, neighbouring communities and the wider environment (Borgmann 2010c, 4). In contrast, fast food is a device that procures eating as a commodity that is made ubiquitously, instantaneously, safely and easily available. This gives food a necessarily isolated and one-dimensional mode of existence. We can consume food without “preparation,” “resonance” or “consequence,” and we do not need to know, care or understand where it comes from. The act of eating in this sense becomes the act of consuming, as the ever-availability of the food disintegrates into snacks and “bites that are grabbed to be eaten.” Just like the digital smartwatch, we recognize the end result, but the means can radically differ. Furthermore, like the smartwatch, the trend towards technological food is toward greater and more prominent availability. A BigMac is prominently available in the way making your own burgers at home simply is not, and so too a smartwatch infinitely increases the availability of information in comparison with a mechanical watch, which tells us only the time. Therefore, the radical novelty of modern technology lies in this duality, that of the interchangeability and concealment of means in contrast with the stability and prominence of ends.

The process by which the means and context proper to an end result become variable and concealed is what Borgmann describes as “moral commodification.” Moral commodification occurs when a thing or practice has been detached from its wider context and becomes a “free-floating object” (Borgmann 2006, 159). Moral commodification can exist with or without what Borgmann calls “economic commodification,” the typical understanding of commodification where something is brought into the market for sale. An example of something that is economically commodified but not morally so would be a farmer’s market, where people are purchasing fresh produce (economic commodification) but this produce remains within its context, meaning it is intimate with its environment and the community relations that such arrangements inspire. In contrast, McDonald’s food is both economically commodified (available for sale) but also morally commodified in the sense that it is severed from its context. The burger appears through the drive-thru window without any indication of the origin of its raw ingredients—beef, vegetables and bread—or the process by which it was prepared. Through this concealment of the process, the food we eat has become abstracted and we subsequently become disenfranchised from participation in, or knowledge of, its origin, production and effects (see Borgmann 2010a).

For this reason, a homemade burger is a “thing” in comparison with fast food (device), which procures for us a BigMac (commodity). While a BigMac and a homemade burger might appear to achieve the same end—sustenance and subjective pleasure—their respective modes of existence are distinct. To think that they are the same thing only achieved differently is therefore a deceiving intuition common to modernity, ultimately implying that the conclusion is crucial and the context dispensable. In reality, it is difficult to see how means and ends could be so radically distorted without doing a certain level of “violence” to the phenomena in and of itself.

In this sense, up until the modern age, there has usually been symmetry of competence in the production and use of tools. For example, a blacksmith needed strength and skill to make an ax, and so did the woodsman who used it. This principle of symmetry explains how our relationship with objects and the environment has subsequently become asymmetrical as a result of the availability procured by devices. The more devices that develop in order to make available commodities on demand—without the concomitant effort, skill or attention—the more our engagement with the world atrophies. This has both phenomenological implications, the loss of relatedness with the world, along with ethical ones. Living a life characterized by constant availability inspires indolence, resentment and greed, and on Borgmann’s account, is increasingly unfavourable to living the good life.

b. Focal Things, Practices and Celebrations

Borgmann’s project does not simply end with his descriptive analysis of technology as the device paradigm consisting of devices and commodities, but rather turns on the value of focal things and practices and the way in which the device paradigm has come to displace them. Unlike devices, focal things and practices underpin the intercourse of human skill, attention and care with our environments, communities and the wider world. It is for this reason that Borgmann’s version of the good life consists of engagement and symmetry, the kind that is bound up in focal things and practices.

Focal is adapted from the Latin word focus which means hearth, whereas “focus” in English has come to relate to optics; something that is made central, clear and articulate. By combining this etymology, Borgmann points to the fact that focal things provide both the orienting power to gather and the focusing power to articulate what is clear and central. In this sense, focality is not simply an existential conception of what makes our lives meaningful, but those things and practices which shape the contours of our values, communities and structure of daily life.

Focal things also provide for manifold engagement, such as the classic fireplace example, where a fireplace not only provides for warmth, but also provides the structure and orientation of family life and the skills attendant to gathering the wood and keeping the fire going.

In his more religious works, Borgmann analogizes the “graceful sacred” with that of focality insofar as a sacred thing commands our respect and devotion, and lends us a sense of gratitude and place within the world (Borgmann 2015a, 4). This is made especially clear in what Borgmann describes as his “focal affirmations,” which he adopted from the Greek concept of kairos, “the right time,” or the moment of grace. The affirmation goes as follows: “There is no place I would rather be. There is no one I would rather be with. There is nothing I would rather do. And this I will remember well” (Borgmann 2024, 80). Therefore, focal things and the practices that sustain them are inherently unifying experiences. There is a unity of achievement and enjoyment of mind, body and environment, of competence and challenge, and of the here and now with the past and future.

Seen this way, focal things and practices are not merely enjoyable hobbies, but constitute the knitting together of a life that is purposeful, skillful and moral. They make us feel “at home” in the world, providing us with a form of “wealth” which is distinct from “affluence,” the procuring of ever more commodities. Focal practices provide a profound “commerce” with reality and a full disclosure of other people, and therefore cannot be bought, reproduced or made available on demand by way of devices.

Importantly, focality is not simply the eliciting of a certain mental or emotional state, a state that could then be procured through a functionally equivalent device more instantaneously, ubiquitously and easily. Focality is not only about pleasure or enjoyment, but often entails tedium, hard work and discomfort. Indeed, in cases where focality is wrongly abstracted as a subjective state, we find devices have come to be developed to commodify and make available that given sensation, such as in the case of pornography.

Throughout his work Borgmann details numerous examples of focal things, practices and places, including athletic examples such as running, skiing, raising horses, baseball, and those of literacy and the arts, including storytelling, writing and reading which he terms “the culture of the word” (Borgmann 2003, 21, Borgmann 1992a, 143). He also discusses religious worship, nature activities and wilderness, and frequently food, the harvesting, preparing and sharing of which he describes as the “culture of the table.” The practice of the culture of the table represents a “gathering” of our world—it gathers our family and friends to a festive occasion such as Thanksgiving, or, in daily life, the restful conclusion to a stressful day. This culture of the table therefore embodies certain skills and virtues that beget the Borgmannian good life, and a practice that transcends cultural and class boundaries, having existed throughout human history (Borgmann 1984, 245).

On the topic of culture, it is important to denote the collective and social side to focality, that of festivity and celebration (Borgmann 1996, 39). For Borgmann, focal practices like cooking are found in the personal sphere, and in the public sphere they come to fruition as communal celebrations, such as farmers markets (Borgmann 2006, 159-160). Communal celebrations are centred on some “concrete” focal thing that entails joyful, shared engagement with the physical presence and radiance of that thing (Borgmann 2003, 48). In other words, celebration is not simply the sharing of focal things and practices with others, but a way in which focality manifests itself amongst a group of people in relation to a certain place and time.

Borgmann’s conception of festivity is loosely based on the premodern European village, where life was oriented around the seasons, nobility and church, and the Medieval calendar included numerous celebratory feast days and communal festivals for rich and poor alike. Borgmann argues that our “public aspirations” for shared community and purpose are “haunted to this day” by life within a village community focused around this festive splendour of religious and feudal celebrations. In contrast, public life had begun to decline by the 19th century:

It was a subtle sort of atrophy that was initially accompanied by an outward expansion of public facilities. This was the time when railway stations, department stores, libraries and the open houses were erected as magnificent setting for the public to gather and enjoy itself. But the people who filled these spaces had become silent, passive and distracted (Borgmann 2003, 38).

Instead of active participants in public life and culture, people came to be transformed into the passive recipients and consumers of public spaces, spaces that were designed, curated and surveilled by experts to make available a specific kind of experience. In other words, shared public culture came to be seen as “scenery” rather than something to be enacted and engaged with.

To rectify this, Borgmann argues that we must discover and nurture public spaces, particularly neglected and ghettoized inner cities and slums. This includes the restoration of historic and heritage buildings, promotion of nature areas, waterfronts, beaches and trails, and accessible open spaces where people can gather (Borgmann 1984, 244). In Crossing the Postmodern Divide Borgmann elaborates that public policy should prioritize various forms of infrastructure necessary for the arts and athletics, such as sports fields, tennis courts, jazz festivals and other related places and events necessary for creating a sense of community and celebration.

More controversially, Borgmann argues in Power Failure for the public funding and endorsement of religious celebrations and events. This is justified on the basis that religious celebration is both an engaging and reflective celebration, where one not only participates in shared festivity, but also one’s sense of place, purpose and tradition is reflected upon. Borgmann also points to the popularity of religion in the United States—the fact that the majority of people identify with some form of religious or spiritual denomination—making it the deepest source of shared orientation, and therefore, one that should not be ignored by public policy (Borgmann 2003, 52-53).

Borgmann sees this public endorsement as inherently necessary, given that festivity is inherently unstable when left to voluntary private associations, it is consistently at risk and already publicly underwritten through such mechanisms as bylaws or tax advantages which incentivize corporate funding (Borgmann 1992a, 140). So too, Borgmann argues that in practice, public infrastructure can never be entirely neutral, it is always a question of how the government should involve itself in tangibly shaping our lives and communities. For this reason, he is often critical of liberalism, given that liberalism presumes to leave the good life open while simultaneously adopting and promoting a definitive style of life, that of the good life as the procurement of availability through devices. He is likewise critical of conservatives. While conservatives have a definitive view of the good life, they frequently undermine their moral commitments by supporting economic policies that contradict their professed moral values. On Borgmann’s account, both sides of the political spectrum are thereby remiss in their refusal to recognize how technology defines and largely determines our lives to the detriment of focal things, practices and celebrations. Reform, then, consists in making a space for public discourse about focal things—what he terms “deictic discourse”—and collectively affirming the need to restrain consumption and support infrastructure which fosters the good life, a life of engagement with focal things, practices and celebrations.

c. Hyperreality and Technological Information

In Borgmann’s middle period, roughly the 90s to the early 00s, he became increasingly concerned with the metaphysical and moral implications of the (nascent) internet and online spaces, that which he describes as creating a “hyperreality.” Therefore, there is an ontological distinction between physical reality and hyperreality.

For Borgmann, hyperreality has three characteristics: the first is that hyperreality is “brilliant,” meaning that it has some form of sensory immersion. Borgmann notes that a “truly brilliant hyperreality,” is one that encompasses all of our senses. However, this kind of hyperreality does not yet exist, and those currently available are relatively poor substitutes to physical reality, given that they only immerse our audible and visual capacities. The level of brilliance or immersion of hyperreality can be determined by the “absence of noise,” meaning anything which disturbs the user’s immersion in the hyperreal. An example of this would be when a video game lags—meaning it loads slowly—disrupting the user’s immersion in the game and preventing proper gameplay. Technical issues with virtual or online environments subsequently “betray the presence of the machinery” and affect the brilliance or immersion within the hyperreality. Borgmann’s second characteristic is what he terms “pliability.” Hyperreality is pliable insofar as it is subject to the user’s desires and manipulation in a way that material reality, with its contrasts, simply is not. The final characteristic is that of “richness” in terms of what the hyperreal experience can provide. Because hyperreality is a device that procures for us information or experiences on demand, hyperreality has no limit in what it can, or will, eventually be able to provide.

The collective term Borgmann uses for these characteristics is “glamour.” Ultimately, the telos of hyperreality is one that aims at a “perfectly glamorous simulator.” Importantly, the simulation in this sense is not merely a reproduction of the physical world but an experience that goes beyond reproduction, to providing us with what is decidedly impossible to achieve in material reality. Hyperreality, therefore, is more real than physical reality.

To illustrate this, Borgmann gives the example of a jogger deciding if she should move to accept a job offer. The jogger greatly enjoys her runs through the mountains near her house and is concerned that by moving, she will no longer be able to undertake this activity. Her employer offers her a membership to a gym to compensate for this loss, but evidently, the two are not equivalent—running on a treadmill in a crowded gym is not the same as running through the wilderness. But suppose her employer were able to offer her access to a running simulator that could entirely simulate the experience of running through her favourite mountain paths. Such a simulator does not only visually or audibly simulate the mountainous environment, but includes the smell of the pines and the feeling of the fresh air on her face—in such a perfect simulator, the user feels as “captivated” and “exhilarated” by it as the real thing (Borgmann 1992a, 87-88).

Whether the run is in a physical or hyperreal landscape, we are inclined to say that insofar as the experience of the user is the same, they are ultimately equivalent. However, Borgmann argues that there are nonetheless “profound differences.” While hyperreality and reality may result in the same experience—there is a clear difference in the “experiential force” of hyperreality compared with physical reality. Experience is not the “sum total of sensor stimulation,” but rather, should be understood as an encounter of a “person with the world.” Considering experience as merely sensory perception ignores the context in which one is oriented within the world. In the case of online social interactions, for example, one may feel as if their interactions are equivalent given that one is really communicating with others on Facebook, developing relationships and participating in a community, but this interaction is devoid of the “force” of context, since there is no genuine encounter with the world or other people—the encounter, rather, is mediated through a digital, hyperreal environment.

Hyperreality is not equivalent to physical reality because hyperreality is “disposable” and “discontinuous.” Hyperreal experiences are “disposable” given that they can be called up at a whim and disposed of at any time, and discontinuous since they lack the force of context and orientation intrinsic to physical reality. The jogger does not need to commit to driving to the mountains, unpacking her gear, and braving the weather to complete her jog, she can enter and exit the simulator at will, and if she likes, choose to run in any number of simulated environments—whether that be a tropical rainforest or an olympic stadium. The encumbering confines of physical space and time mean nothing in hyperreality, meaning that hyperreality lacks the mode of existence in which physical reality demands—continuity and commitment (Borgmann 1992a, 96-97).

Borgmann was prescient in predicting that the internet would result in an “encompassing communal structure” and that online networks would become the fundamental “infrastructure” of this future world. However, despite the widespread assumption of a “global village” that provides us with the ability to be in touch with everyone all the time, Borgmann argues that the ubiquity of universal connection ultimately serves to disconnect us from one another. Because hyperreal space is inherently discontinuous and disposable, one is always “indifferently present” and never “commandingly present,” thereby we are deprived of both physically interacting with others and from the instruction of being seen and judged by them (Borgmann 1992, 97). Intuitively, this “openness” of online space ignites behaviour and hostility that would be unthinkable for many people in their physical interactions (Borgmann 1999, 5). Where physical interaction requires commitment and continuity, hyperreality is the opposite. The disposability and discontinuity of the hyperreal in this sense has the power to make someone feel as if they are omniscient and omnipotent, and therefore goes to explain much of the behaviour we witness online.

For this reason, Borgmann rejects the potential for a focal conception of the internet or virtual reality. In other words, the internet cannot be used as a way to mediate social relations because the kind of “instrumental” community made available by way of the internet is not equivalent to that of “final communities,” those which are possible only by the fullness of reality, the bodily presence of people and the commanding presence of things (Borgmann 2004, 97). Borgmann’s emphasis on tangible, material things which radiate meaning within a defined and continuous context means that hyperreality, such as the internet or virtual reality, will never be equivalent to material reality, ontologically or morally. Indeed, the good life is necessarily the embodied life, and therefore it is in focal things, practices, and celebration that we find the grounding necessary to contradict the essential disorientation of the internet, that which Borgmann describes as “focal realism.” Instead of going online to make friends, exchange ideas or to debate, we must seek these focal practices in their native realm—that of the physical world—and invigorate physical reality as the rightful place for these kinds of practices.

In Holding On to Reality (1999) Borgmann extends his earlier discussions of hyperreality to the ontology of online communication and information. Here, Borgmann presents a relational model of information, which subsequently differentiates between the structure of information and the way information has evolved. At base, the structure of information consists of INTELLIGENCE (the capacity to recognize) providing a PERSON the ability to recognize a SIGN about a THING in a certain CONTEXT. Using this definition Borgmann constructs a triadic model of the historical evolution of information.

Historically, information evolved within what Borgmann terms the “ancestral environment,” and served the purposes of informing us about our environment, which he describes as “natural signs.” In order to survive, our ancestors were required to pay careful attention to the “presence of things,” and what these phenomena came to represent (SIGNS) in a certain CONTEXT. For example, a sudden drop in temperature may indicate that a storm is coming, or that an edible species of plant can be differentiated from a toxic species on the basis of its leaf shape. Natural signs such as these are subtle and can be difficult to recognize and interpret, given that the sign is sent by a thing-itself, rather than a person, and therefore does not address us directly. Natural signs do not stand out in the natural environment, but rather are coherent within the environment, requiring an individual to recognize and adapt to the things-themselves to extract the significance (Borgmann 1999, 25-30).

As the human species evolved, natural information gave way to a new form of information, that of “conventional signs.” Conventional signs, in contrast with natural signs, are set apart from the natural environment, and are intentional, not incidental, meaning that they address us directly and are meant to be understood. Conventional signs are about and from reality, meaning that they represent additional information for reality. In simpler terms, they constitute some form of cultural information. Conventional signs began with objects, such as a cairn to mark a sacred burial site, and evolved to counting and written language (Borgmann 1999, 41). A contemporary example is that of traffic symbols. A downward facing red triangle (SIGN) posted near a road (CONTEXT) is meant to inform the driver to yield to oncoming traffic (THING), or a black caricature of a moose (SIGN) is meant to inform a driver to be weary of moose crossing the road (THING). These kinds of symbols are conventional signs, insofar as they convey the cultural information necessary for driving.

Cultural information therefore serves, in some form or another, a way of recording, engaging with or enriching reality. Borgmann discusses a few examples frequently, including maps, recipes, reports, musical scores, or architectural blueprints. All of these objects contain information for the transformation of reality in some way, while simultaneously requiring a person to realize them, that is, to read or otherwise understand the information they contain in order to actualize the result. A recipe book does not give you a pie, but it tells you how you can engage with reality in such a way to make one. Therefore, cultural information still requires some kind of engagement with the world. Indeed, Borgmann cites reading, playing music or performing poetry as focal examples where cultural information forces engagement with our intelligence and imagination and subsequently comes to enrich our perspective and illuminate our relationship with the world (see Borgmann 2012 and Borgmann 1990).

What Borgmann terms “technological information” differs from natural and cultural information on the basis that it presents information as reality, rather than merely about or for reality, and therefore represents a rival to reality. Drawing on the characteristics of hyperreality, technological information is richer, more brilliant and more pliable than cultural or natural information, and therefore more real than reality itself. Consider for example, the richness of information available by way of Google. It would be impossible to contain such a magnitude of information in traditional printed books, or even in any given physical library.

Technological information is also self-realizing, meaning that it does not require a human to decipher or engage with it for its realization. Contrasting that of a musical score (cultural information) with the case of a CD (technological information), Borgmann illustrates that a CD, as a device, provides the music on demand with no requirement of skill, effort or engagement. In contrast, a musical score requires a person to learn how to read music, and perhaps how to play an instrument, in order to actualize the information it contains (the music). In this way, like physical forms of devices—such as the microwave or fast food—technological information serves as a device to procure greater and more prominent information, so much so that it comes to displace the skills necessary to appropriate physical reality. Technological information supplants material reality and gives us what we want without concomitant skill and engagement.

Due to the brilliance and abundance of technological information, Borgmann predicts that distraction will become the “mental counterpart to obesity.” Just as the overabundance of convenient and alluring food devices (e.g. fast food) led people to eating too much, the overabundance of technological information, such as in the case of the internet, has led to diversion and distraction, people consuming information without skill, attention or discretion (see Borgmann 2010c). The internet therefore represents a gateway to diversion and has an inherent disorienting effect (Borgmann 1998, 145).

Borgmann argues that this is especially prevalent in education, where an emphasis on using digital devices has led to a loss of attention, reduced comprehension and an inability for students to fully absorb themselves in what they are reading. Furthermore, not only do digital devices threaten our cognitive skills, such as attention and comprehension, but as Borgmann also highlights, knowledge itself has been reshaped by the immediate availability of information. He argues in “Information and Education at the Turn of the Century” (1998) that students are increasingly taught to think like a computer, insofar as having a global database of instantly available information at hand means that students are taught how to find information, rather than expected to know genuine and actual knowledge:

In both the computer and the person, the complement to ‘having the world database at your fingertips’ is to have nothing in your head. The case of technological information here takes the shape of a distinctive kind of liberty-liberation from the burdens of memory and the freedom to summon up whatever information. Such liberty, alas, approximates vacuity, and while empty-headed computers can count on the guidance of their users, empty-headed persons are at the mercy of the whims of society and culture (Borgmann 1998, 148-149).

To reclaim the focal depth of reading and learning, Borgmann insists upon a return to tangible places, such as traditional in-person schools and campuses, libraries, and physical books (Borgmann 2012, 197).

3. Ethics and Technology

For Borgmann, modern technology operates by way of consent and complicity, which means that modern technology necessarily becomes a moral problem, and one that has been largely neglected by contemporary ethicists. Borgmann insists that the choices we make in our individual lives and collectively, as a community, tend towards endorsing the further entrenchment of devices. Therefore, we are all complicit in accepting the good life as one that can only be realized technologically, that is, by way of devices that procure the availability of commodities.

In contrast, focal things and practices involve a moral ethic, which can redeem us from the vacuity, apathy and complicity of modern technological life. The things, practices and places that we engage with and come to orient our lives inspire moral virtues of personal excellence, skill and fidelity. As seen with the example of the culture of the table, the cooking and sharing of a meal involves not only effort and skill, but implies patience, friendship and dedication. Likewise, focal places, such as wilderness, inspire a certain kind of reverence and care, an attitude that serves as a stark contrast with the availability of ever more commodities to be procured by way of devices (see Borgmann 2015a). Focal things, practices, events and places all involve moral fecundity and subsequently constitute the good life.

Throughout his work, Borgmann emphasizes that the device paradigm and modern technology have fundamental moral consequences, consequences that are overlooked when technology is viewed as neutral, or in a piecemeal evaluation of particular technologies. However, Borgmann becomes especially concerned in his later work with the moral implications of technologies—largely in response to the increasing advancement of technologies such as virtual reality and artificial intelligence—and how, notwithstanding these innovations, individuals and communities can foster moral excellence and a life of depth and meaning.

a. Real Ethics: Philosophy of Place and Virtue Ethics

In his discussion of the good life, Borgmann follows traditional virtue ethics in positing a theory of moral excellence, one that involves cultivating a certain moral character and subsequent moral skills. However, Borgmann sets his work apart from other virtue ethicists with his emphasis on what he calls “real ethics,” the emphasis that our surroundings are morally relevant, and that reality is ultimately “ethically charged at every level”:

It matters morally whether you have a TV in your home or not; and if you do, it matters what kind of TV have […] It is ethically consequential where you place the set, whether in the middle of the living room or out of the way (Borgmann 2006, 29).

Therefore, in contrast to modern ethical theories which assume that morality informs the environment, a Borgmannian real ethics investigates the moral structures of the material culture on the premise of what he terms the Churchill Principle—that shaping our tangible environment subsequently shapes our lives.

Given his emphasis on the role of design, architecture and infrastructure in shaping human conduct and attitudes, Borgmann’s ethical work involves the philosophy of place. For example, urban spaces today largely consist of either instrumental space—such as highways, parking garages, office buildings—or consumption space, in the form of retail centres, shopping malls and other venues which procure entertainment commodities. Accordingly, these spaces result in a mood of indifference and passivity, for example, one mall is very much like the other (Borgmann 2003, 40-49). To address this apathy and consumerism, these public spaces must be designed to encourage community and celebration. So too, on an individual level, careful thought should be put into the design and layout of one’s home to encourage engagement and focal practices, such as reading or eating dinner as a family, over devices and consumption (see Borgmann 1995a, 18).

Borgmann also insists that to some degree, our evolution as a species goes to determine the conditions in which human beings prosper, both materially and morally, and therefore we must develop the acumen to recognize when we have strayed too far from these evolutionary arrangements. Borgmann observes how a sense of purpose, bodily engagement and meaningful social interaction track human well being, and these in turn track the traditional virtues of wisdom, courage and friendship (Borgmann 2013a, 6). This influence of evolutionary psychology is especially evident in his final essays, where he describes the redeeming qualities of tangible, natural environments and concomitant practices that involve the regular exercise of manual skills alongside an involvement with local community (see Borgmann 2023). One can see how his emphasis on the tangible, local and communal map onto his most frequently discussed focal things and practices, such as gardening, sports and cooking.

Therefore, alongside the Churchill Principle and Borgmann’s work on architecture and design, Borgmann adapts traditional virtues to address the unique moral challenges and vices attendant in our technological lives.

This is not unlike, as he notes, how Aristotle struggled with the shift from a heroic to civic conception of courage (Borgmann 2000c, 69). So too, today we must determine, for example, the proper setting and exercise of courage in the modern environment, an environment that is rarely brutal or dangerous. The symmetry between human life and our environment means that our need for courage has declined in relation to the ways our lives have been made more convenient, comfortable and efficient through devices and the availability of commodities (Borgmann 2006, 106). However, this does not mean that courage has become superfluous, but rather, “fortitude,” the modern descendant of courage, must instead become one of the defining virtues of our era (Borgmann 2003, 116). Most of us today do not face dangers that call for the kind of fearless courage of our ancestors, but instead, by virtue of the devices surrounding us, we face the constant temptation to do what is commodious, comfortable and convenient (Borgmann 2006, 171). Should we go for a run or watch TV? Should I labour through Plato’s Republic or ask AI for a summary? In this sense, Borgmann conceives of fortitude as the ability to persevere against the temptation to do what is easy or comfortable (Borgmann 2006, 116). Fortitude is not only necessary to resisting the urge to do that which is commodious, convenient or comfortable, but therefore also necessary for making room in one’s life for focal things and practices and the related virtues that these things and practices engender. So too, the virtue of “economy” speaks to our ability to restrain ourselves in the technological environment of abundance, and determine what requires our attention, effort and engagement. The virtue of “design” is the virtue of taking responsibility for our built environments. Other Borgmannian virtues include that of “grace,” the ability to be moved by the arts and religion, and “patience,” the ability to endure the burdens and constraints of material reality.

These virtues and the focal things, practices, and celebrations that engender them, go to counteract many of the moral vices that Borgmann sees latent within technological culture and the device paradigm. This includes indolence—the avoidance of exertion and challenge— and resentment. When good fortune appears, we feel it to be our just desserts, yet when met with misfortune, we are indignant and angry:

When misery comes to our doorstep unexpected and uninvited, resentment rushes into the words I don’t need that. What makes that expression so whiny and self-righteous? The words imply that someone mistakenly thought we needed a child, a disabled parent, or a car wreck or some other misfortune. And underlying that implication is the deeper assumption that one is the legitimate recipient only of things one incontestably needs. Since a burden is not such thing, it is incomprehensible at best and thought to be morally outrageous at worst (Borgmann 1992a, 10).

This attitude of entitlement is made especially widespread by virtue of the device paradigm, which functions on the basis of availability. So too, we become frustrated and resentful when something does not go our way or we do not get what we want when we want it.

As noted earlier, the device paradigm functions by way of complicity. We might not like the way things are but we are reluctant to act on this sense or take responsibility (Borgmann 1984, 173). Complicity lends itself to a greater moral consequence, that of regret:

We watch on TV what and where we would like to be, outside, somewhere, bravely and skillfully facing real challenges; but we never get around to doing and being what we watch. That is the reason why the moral concern that the typical human condition inspires today is not outrage […] but the sort of searing regret one feels when something beautiful is being defaced by neglect (Borgmann 2000a, 198).

Because modern technology introduces a range of new possibilities, there is an inherent sense of cultural and individual regret that these possibilities are largely unrealized, and instead, technology pursues ever more commodious aims. While Borgmann’s paradigmatic account entails that there are “hard constraints” that, for example, require people to rely on cars, buy unhealthy food and use digital devices, the way to rectifying these constraints is by making choices that resist availability and foster the good life of engagement and the cultivation of excellence (Borgmann 2013a, 7). On Borgmann’s account then, to resolve complicity and regret we must overcome the passivity encouraged by technological devices and take moral responsibility for our lives and our material surroundings. This begins with both cultivating virtues, but also recognizing the way we can design our environments to foster these virtues and the focal practices that lend themselves to the good life.

b. Christian Ethics: Poverty and Grace

As a Catholic, Borgmann frequently wrote about Christianity and its role in technological culture. Power Failure is his topical work on this subject, but throughout his corpus he draws attention to the gathering and orienting power of religion, and the resulting moral virtues that Christianity, and religious worship more generally, teaches and imparts. Borgmann frequently notes religion as a primary, if not predominant, form of focal thing and practice, and religious places (or religious-like places, such as wilderness) in their emphasis on reflection, piety, and reverence, are especially focal.

Christian ethics also largely informs Borgmann’s work on social justice and his concern with wealth inequality. In particular, he argues that the device paradigm breeds a unique form of moral apathy, a lack of concern for injustice and the poor. Paradoxically, he describes our contemporary moral state as that of “advanced poverty”: the incapacity to be appropriately moved by misery, to appreciate what we have and care for those who do not share our good fortune.

For Borgmann, this explains the general apathy we feel towards the poor and suffering in our own communities and the global poor in developing countries. In contrast with the “advanced poverty” of technological culture, Borgmann describes modern instances of, for example, famine or homelessness, as “brute poverty.” It is an especially brutal and bitter form of poverty because it represents largely unnecessary suffering (Borgmann 1987, 186). In this sense, brutal poverty on both the global and local scale is a scandal, an example of the deep moral failing of technology and our technological culture. Despite having the means to prevent starvation and diseases, provide shelter to the homeless and develop governments that are stable and peaceable, for one reason or another we do not, nor do most people watching the news on television particularly care.

Things such as disease and famine are universal throughout human history, and so too, presumably, is apathy towards such catastrophes. Yet, what is historically unique is that modern technology now provides us with the capacity to do something about it. This ability is therefore both metaphysically significant, in terms of the distinction between premodern forms of tools and modern technology, and ethically significant, given that it leads to this state of advanced poverty. It is largely for this reason that Borgmann claims that technology has failed to live up to its promise, while at the same time, it has paradoxically achieved too much. Instead of following through with the constructive phase and its promise of material liberation from hunger and disease, technology has largely degenerated into producing that which is trivial, nonsensical and gluttonous, while people still go hungry and die of preventable causes.

In order to amend this apathy and moral poverty, we must then turn to focal concerns to determine what really matters. Turning towards focality is therefore a way to resolve our advanced poverty while at the same time drawing attention and resources—which are currently used towards procuring more commodities—towards these sorts of genuine problems. Throughout his work, Borgmann emphasizes the need to restrain the consumption of commodities and the ubiquity of devices. Borgmann calls on Christians to lead by example and dedicate themselves to practices that counteract technological distraction, overconsumption and frivolity:

We need to extend the force of the sacraments into the dailiness of the sacramentals, those things and practices that represent divine grace in tangible and often inconspicuous ways—sitting down to dinner, reading to one another, making music, engaging the beauty of nature. These are our sources of strength that will enable us to get out from under the envious pursuit of technological affluence and to direct our prosperity toward the relief of the poor and the preservation of the environment. (Borgmann 2008b, 43).

Advanced and brutal poverty contrast with “biblical poverty,” suffering which leads to spiritual enlightenment and humility, the recognition of our fundamental incompleteness in the face of the human condition and the contingencies of our environment (Borgmann 2006, 85). This loss of humility goes to explain why, as discussed above, resentment and entitlement are widespread attitudes in technological culture. Because the device paradigm seeks to control reality to procure commodities that are ever more ubiquitous, safe and easy to use, this sense of contingency is subsequently lost. Contingency is the idiosyncrasy of something, for example, misfortune, luck, disaster or relief, which makes the conditions of grace and salvation possible (Borgmann 2006, 65). Having something made available to you on demand subsequently occludes the role of contingency. The decline of technological progress correlates with the decline of religious faith, which is due in part to this loss of contingency that lends itself to occasions of biblical poverty, grace and salvation (Borgmann 1980). Borgmann’s religious work then, can be read as both a warning to religious communities of declining faith and also as a call to action, that is to demonstrate by example that the good life does not have to consist in greater affluence and availability.

c. Science and the Search for Meaning

Borgmann spent the final years of his career concerned with the question that had occupied him since Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life, that being, how we can live a good life in a technological era. In his final book Moral Cosmology, he turns from ethical answers to the metaphysical origin of this question, and considers how the loss of a shared and comprehensive “moral cosmology” has subsequently led to a loss of finality from which we can derive meaning and genuine moral significance.

A moral cosmology in this sense includes a story and a “conception of the world as a whole,” such as how the world came to be and how this informs the ethics and conduct of human beings. Such a universe is “well-ordered and good,” and Borgmann includes historical examples such as the Christian story of Genesis, Helios for the ancient Greeks, or the Sun Chief for the Blackfoot peoples (Borgmann 2024, 2-3). The cohesion of any given cosmology was guaranteed by its successful transmission from generation to generation, which informed both a culture’s and an individual’s understanding of the world at large. However, a rift within these premodern moral cosmologies occurred when cosmology came to be understood chiefly as a scientific discipline, a rift that has continued up until today. As a result, Borgmann outlines how our nostalgia for a moral cosmology has essentially remained in the same predicament since the eighteenth-century. Through distraction and the loss of those focal activities which centre our lives and provide for meaning and finality, traditional cosmologies have become further encroached upon by modern technology and the device paradigm.

Finality can be found when engaging with focal things and practices. Focal things and practices lead us to say, “there is no place I would rather be. There is no one I would rather be with. There is nothing I would rather do.” In other words, our lives feel complete and whole. This sense of finality, however, is lost amid the relentless production of available commodities, commodities that become ever more available through ever more devices for every human need and every human want. A life of infinite and ever evolving choices and alternatives—choosing amongst food, objects, career, religions, lifestyle, friends, identity, cars to name only a few—is a life that is forever incomplete and therefore constitutes a worldview that ultimately negates finality. As Borgmann writes:

The commodified world is forever incomplete. Completeness, accordingly, is not the cessation of wants and desires simply, but their fulfilment by something other than a commodity […] (Borgmann 2011a, 17).

In this sense, our world of available commodities is a world that is superficial and can never fully satisfy us. Again, for this reason we desire a “deeper reality,” something approaching a coherent and ordered vision of the world like that of premodern cultures, which had a strong sense of their world, how it came to be, what its boundaries were, and who or what, was at its centre. Understanding the natural order of things such as the true nature of beauty and the good, was traditionally encapsulated in the virtue of wisdom. A wise person, in other words, was someone who understood how things came to hang together.

Living in this sort of world came with the clear and inherent sense of completeness and finality. Our modern technological world self-evidently lacks this sort of narrative and the virtue of wisdom. Therefore, the task of finding completeness and finality comes under the unreliable domain of individuals or, more commonly, becomes the “grist” for further technological development and in a similar vein, the role of wisdom has been diluted into superficial platitudes. The alternative, then, is that focality and shared public and collective festivity can help us orient our lives and discern what truly matters. In other words, a focal life is a life that is centred, bounded, and ultimately, complete. So too, the modern need for wisdom must instead be understood as a need for maturity and good judgement—the ability to discern what technology can be useful and which devices, in their production of availability, can hinder or constrain our ability to live this life of focality and completeness (Borgmann 2010c, 4).

While Borgmann is critical of technology, it is important to note that he is frequently laudatory of science. Science, through its disclosing and correcting power, can provide a coherent and detailed view of the world (Borgmann 1984, 21). To feel “at home” in the world, we must construct a moral cosmology that resolves this Enlightenment-era rift between science (what is) and ethics (what we ought to do). One way such compatibility can be found is in “background knowing” that is informed by scientific understanding of both the smallest (quantum physics) and largest (relativity theory) aspects of our universe, thereby allowing us to appreciate our worldview as the middle-ground, a unique place where genuine moral significance can occur (Borgmann 2024, 58). Understanding the basics of physics, then, is key to understanding our place in the world and resolving this rift between science and ethics. In this sense, Borgmann seeks to reconcile modern science with an account that allows for moral significance, and provides this sense of purpose and finality necessary for living a cohesive and fundamentally focal life.

4. Critical Reception and Influence

Given his long history with the philosophy of technology as a discipline—having been a member of the Society for Philosophy of Technology since its inception in 1975— Borgmann was prolific in referencing and responding to a variety of thinkers, past and present, including Ivan Illich, Don Ihde, John Rawls, Lewis Mumford, Langdon Winner, Hubert Dreyfus and Paul Durbin. In addition, David Strong and Eric Higgs have noted Borgmann’s significant role within the American philosophical tradition, a tradition concerned with “the reflective care of the good life,” and includes those such as Ralph Waldo Emerson, Henry Thoreau, Aldo Leopold and Henry Bugbee—the latter of whom was Borgmann’s mentor at the University of Montana (Strong and Higgs 2000, also see American Wilderness Philosophy).

Borgmann’s work has been the subject of numerous articles and, most substantially, an anthology of critical essays, Technology and the Good Life? (2000). These essays—along with a special edition of Techné: Research in Philosophy of Technology 6(1) (2002)—constitute the bulk of the critical and theoretical literature on Borgmann’s framework. The majority of the secondary literature on Borgmann is subsequently applied work, namely case studies where the device paradigm has been applied to a variety of technologies and practices. These topics are extremely varied and include the use of GPS in Inuit communities (Aporta and Higgs 2005), nursing (Walters 1994, Bayou 2024), hunting (Pauley 2003), the TV show Black Mirror (Yeung 2022), fast food (Campisi 2011), farming (Strong 2000, Strong 2016), education in Ghana (Nemorin 2024), the traditions of the Lumad peoples (Imbuing 2023), pastoral care (Boers 2012), Japanese culture (Heikerro 2005) and the smartphone (Roholt 2023). While illuminating, the applied work tends to deal only with the basic device/focality distinction in relation to the chosen topic and sometimes in comparison with other thinkers. Indeed, while Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life, Crossing the Postmodern Divide, and Holding onto Reality generated much critical interest in the late 90s and early 00’s, Real American Ethics resulted in minimal attention and his last book, Moral Cosmology, basically none.

Given that Borgmann was often critical of contemporary analytic approaches to philosophy and technology (see Borgmann “Does Philosophy Matter?” 1995) it is no surprise that many analytic philosophers have taken issue with his holistic view of technology, which subsequently neglects the intricacies of specific technologies and their uses (see Achterhuis 2002).

Larry Hickman is one such critic who highlights, with some suspicion, Borgmann’s use of determinist language to describe modern technology in spite of his attempts to assure readers that he does not hold that view (see also Skrbina 2015). For this reason, Hickman argues that Borgmann shares with the technological determinists an “essentialist” conception of technology where he reduces the functions of a variety of devices down to one essential property. Taking the case of television, Hickman highlights that television does not simply procure the commodity of entertainment, but that it can also serve to inform and educate. Television then, does not have an essential property that determines its function, but rather, we must look to the specific context that informs this function. Talk of an “essence” of technology is therefore unhelpful and misleading (Hickman 2000). Hickman, in a later essay, also rejects Borgmann’s distinction that digital media fails to make the same claims on our capacities as traditional texts (Hickman 2001).

In “From Essentialism to Constructivism: Philosophy of Technology at the Crossroads” (2000) Andrew Feenberg shares Hickman’s concern, noting that Borgmann “remain[s] faithful to the determinist premises of an earlier generation” such as Heidegger and Jacques Ellul, since these thinkers fail to discriminate between different kinds of technology and the relation between technology and social context (Feenberg 2000, 294-295).

By far, the most frequent criticisms of Borgmann relate to the question of focal devices, that is to say, whether some devices are used in a way that is focal or begets focal things and practices. David Skrbina, for example, points to several cases of modern, technologically produced products—like the strings on a guitar—that otherwise go to constitute focal things (Skrbina 2015, 99). So too, Diane Michelfelder argues that the telephone can be used to promote community and engagement (see Michelfelder 2000). Social constructivists, pragmatists and technological enthusiasts are frequent critics of Borgmann’s device paradigm and seek to point out his oversight in recognizing how technology can be used in positive and potentially focal ways. For example, many interlocutors, including Feenberg but also Phillip Fandozzi, Trine Antonsen and Erik Lundested and Peter-Paul Verbeek, have argued that watching (some kinds) of television or film, including the art of film making, can be considered a focal activity.

While there is some ambiguity in what constitutes focality given that Borgmann admits focal things are not amenable to testing or quantifying (see Borgmann 2000b). In response to these criticisms, it should be noted that Borgmann’s distinction between devices and focal things must be interpreted as a continuum rather than as a strict dichotomy (Borgmann 1995b, 225). The continuum between devices and things is moored by extreme cases at either end, the likes of which are the kind Borgmann frequently refers to as examples. Yet, he admits that in between the clearcut cases we often find “intricate and interesting intermediates.” In other words, deviceness is not an “all-or-nothing affair,” but rather, our engagement with the world of things can be “thickened and widened” by degrees (Borgmann 2010b, 34 and Borgmann 1995c, 40).

Borgmann does admit to technological devices that “can be engaging” or “at least support engagement with one’s world.” In a footnote in Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life, Borgmann observes that “technological engagement” exists in cases where focal activities depend on technology, such as alpine skiing or cycling. However, it is not the bike or skis themselves that are engaging, but rather how they mediate this engagement (Borgmann 1984, 288 n. 12). In this case, engaging technological instruments mediate but do not procure engagement, as to procure engagement would be to make it more available by way of a device. Therefore, whether devices can promote focality is a “legitimate question” and depends on the extent to which the technology in question promotes engagement. Importantly, since Borgmann is not an instrumentalist, this depends not only on user intention but also the broad impact of technology, that is to take seriously what focal practices or things have become occluded, negated or replaced by its implementation (Borgmann 2002).

Borgmann’s frequent discussion of traditional, religious and predominantly Western focal practices has also led to allegations that he is “dangerously conservative,” (Cutrofellow 1993, 96, see also Collins 2002, Davidson 2001) or that his theory is vulnerable to use by right-wing reactionaries (Light 2000).

Relatedly, Borgmann’s frequent historical examples of focal practices, places and societies have led to accusations of nostalgia and an unduly romantic view of the past. For example, Nancy Manikko (1992) followed by Pieter Tijimes (1999), Verbeek (2002 and 2005) and Topi Heikkero (2012), argue that premodern and modern activities are inherently incomparable, given that premodern forms of focality were largely acted out of survival and necessity. For example, while having a campfire today is typically an enjoyable outdoor event, building and maintaining a fire or hearth in the premodern era entailed urgency, labor and often drudgery.

In addition, Verbeek points to the fact that in his discussion of focality, Borgmann wrongly conflates two different forms of engagement that came to be displaced by the device paradigm. The first kind of lost engagement is that of the effort or difficulty that was historically required to obtain a result or complete a task, such as how the fireplace came to be displaced by easier and more efficient ways of home heating. The second kind of engagement concerns activities that are intrinsically valuable and therefore entail a sense of meaningfulness. It is the latter that Verbeek argues is properly focal, given that focal things are those objects which do not serve any extrinsic objective. Therefore, Verbeek argues that focal devices can exist on a Borgmannian account, given that technology typically leads to a reduction of effort-as-engagement but only indirectly threatens focal engagement-as-meaning, properly understood as autotelic. For this reason, technology does not render focal engagement impossible, but rather, in many cases, introduces new sources of engagement, such as how a person can be focally engaged with a CD player or microwave. While CD players and microwaves might reduce the amount of effort-as-engagement, they can inversely increase engagement-as-meaning, insofar as CD players allow more people to listen to music, and microwaves invite a “more complex cooking process” (Verbeek 2005, 187-190).

Likewise, Borgmann has been described as overly “paternalistic” in his unequivocal conception of the good life and objective framework of moral excellence, insofar as he neglects that the good life for some may involve television watching or enjoying a commodious life. Those who believe that human well-being is ultimately subjective, or who otherwise support a more liberal principle of non-interference in other’s lives and choices, will therefore take issue with some of Borgmann’s arguments and resulting moral evaluations (see Antonsen and Lundstead 2019, Waelbars and Briggle 2010). However some, such as Robert-Jan Geerts, have defended the value of Borgmann’s normative view of the good life, pointing to the fact that Borgmann effectively highlights how our social structures and environments are far from neutral and that most people—exempting subjectivists—can benefit from being called to reflect on their own choices and the pattern of their daily lives (Geerts 2017). Antonsen and Lundstead highlight that Borgmann’s theory of design is supported by empirical findings in behavioural economics surrounding the efficacy of “nudging” behaviour, where the material environment can be arranged to encourage certain choices over others (Antonsen and Lundstead 2019).

Critics also point to the fact that some people may not have the time or resources needed for focal practices, or otherwise have to rely on devices to survive (Michelfelder 2000, Wood 2006). For example, Michael Power argues that only the “heroic or saintly” are able to live the kind of engaging life Borgmann imagines, given that social institutions outside of our control fundamentally dictate our lives (Power 2000, 292). Borgmann’s response is to acknowledge the inducements of the device paradigm but to reiterate the role of agency in resisting this paradigm. We can subsequently assert this agency through the fostering of individual focal practices, the development of infrastructure to support shared festivity and by making space for public deictic discourse.

The extent to which the implementation of Borgmann’s ideas of resisting the device paradigm is actually feasible for most people is a debatable question. Borgmann himself has admitted that his reformative suggestions, such as regularly eating dinner as a family, putting the television in the basement or funding jazz festivals and baseball fields, may seem like “pretty weak tea” in the face of severe global problems such as climate change and inequality. Therefore, it is not surprising that several critics have argued that Borgmann’s suggestions for reform are “remarkably scant,” (Hickman 1992: 344) and lack constructive criteria (Feenberg 2000, see also Mitcham 2000, Davidson 2001). Borgmann’s disagreement with Marxism (see Stanley 1988) and rejection of revolutionary politics has likewise led to some criticism that Borgmann is more concerned with “preaching” than actual action (Durbin 2015). Skrbina argues that Borgmann’s reform plan is naively optimistic, insofar as it does not take seriously the existential threat of global warming and wide scale ecological collapse (Skrbina 2015).

Notwithstanding these various criticisms, Borgmann’s work played a foundational role in the development of the American branch of the philosophy of technology from the 1980s through the early 2000’s, and his work continues to inspire discussion and interest today. Borgmann was a lucid and prescient skeptic of technology, but, and perhaps more importantly, remained optimistic in spite of his skepticism. He believed that the world we inhabit is fundamentally good and that the good life is still within reach. In this sense, Borgmann’s writings provide some much-needed hope to the next generation of philosophers and the general public alike.

5. References and Further Reading

A repository of Borgmann’s manuscripts, unpublished writing, correspondence, teaching materials and personal artifacts is held at the University of Montana, Mansfield Library, Archives and Special Collections (Albert Borgmann Papers 1951-2020). See below for a comprehensive list of Borgmann’s publications (primary materials) and select secondary materials.

a. Primary Sources

Given the lack of an authoritative bibliography, below is a chronological list of Borgmann’s publications, including the entirety of his published essays (exempting book reviews, duplicate publications and excerpts published in multiple venues).

i. Books

The Philosophy of Language: Historical Foundations and Contemporary Issues. Martinus Nijoff, 1974.
Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life: A Philosophical Inquiry. University of Chicago Press, 1984.
Crossing the Postmodern Divide. University of Chicago Press, 1992a.
Holding On to Reality: The Nature of Information at the Turn of the Millennium. University of Chicago Press, 1999a.
Power Failure: Christianity in the Culture of Technology. Brazos Press, 2003.
Real American Ethics: Taking Responsibility for Our Country. University of Chicago Press, 2006.
Moral Cosmology: On Being in the World Fully and Well. Lexington Books, 2024.
Articles:

ii. Articles

“Language in Heidegger’s Philosophy.” Journal of Existentialism 7, no. 26 (1966): 161-180.
“The Transformation of Heidegger’s Thought.” Personalist 47, no. 4 (1966): 484-499.
“Philosophy and the Concern for Man.” Philosophy Today 10, no. 4 (1966): 236-246.
“The Place of Theology in a Technological World.” NICEA Bulletin 64 (1968): 28-33.
“Technology and Reality.” Man and World 4, no. 1 (1971):59-69.
- Borgmann’s first independent article on technology. It is in this article that he would begin formulating what would become this theory of the device paradigm in Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life.
“Orientation in Technology.” Philosophy today 16, no. 2 (1972): 135-147.
“Functionalism in Science and Technology.” Proceedings on the XVth World Congress of Philosophy (1975): 31-36.
“The Explanation of Technology.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 1 (1978): 99-118.
- Borgmann, alongside Carl Mitcham and Paul Durbin helped establish this annual journal following the advent of the Society for Philosophy and Technology. This journal would later become what is known today as Techné: Research in Philosophy and Technology.
“Freedom and Determinism in a Technological Setting.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 2 (1979): 79-90.
“Should Montana Share its Coal? Technology and Public Policy.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 3 (1980): 287-311.
“Christianity and the Cultural Center of Gravity.” Listening 18, no. 2 (1983): 93-102.
- Borgmann’s first explicit work on questions relating to technology and Christianity. This essay was subsequently revised and republished as “Prospects for the Theology of Technology” in Theology and Technology (1984) edited by Carl Mitcham and Jim Grote.
“The Good Life and Appropriate Technology.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 6 (1983): 11-19.
“Liberty, Festivity and Poverty: Harvey Cox on Christianity.” Philosophy Today 30, no. 3 (1986): 163-167.
- While primarily a response to Harvey Cox’s work, here Borgmann introduces some of his religious themes which will ultimately develop into Power Failure (2003).
“Cosmopolitanism and Provincialism: On Heidegger’s Error and Insights.” Philosophy Today 36, no. 2 (1992): 131-145.
“Artificial Intelligence and Human Personality.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 14 (1994): 271-283.
“Theory, Practice, Reality.” Inquiry 38 no.1-2 (1995): 143-156.
“Does Philosophy Matter?” Technology in Society 17, no. 3 (1995): 295-309.
- In this essay Borgmann discusses the value and future of academic philosophy as both a discipline and as a profession.
“Postmodern Ontology.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 15 (1995b): 223-226.
“The Meaning of Technology.” The World and I (1996): 289-299.
“Technology and the Crisis of the Contemporary.” Proceedings of the American Catholic Philosophical Association 70 (1996): 33-44.
“Information and Education at the Turn of the Century.” Bridges 5 (1998): 133-153.
“A Scarcity of Focal Things and Practices: Reply to Pieter Tijmes.” Technology in Society 21, no. 2 (1999): 191-199.
“Society in the Postmodern Era.” The Washington Quarterly 23, no. 1 (2000a): 189-200.
“Gender, Nature and Fidelity.” Ethics and the Environment 4, no. 2 (2000): 131-142.
“The Moral Complexion of Consumption.” The Journal of Consumer Research 26, no. 4 (2000): 418-422.
“Opaque and Articulate Design.” International Journal of Technology and Design Education 11, no. 1 (2001): 5-11.
“Contingency and Grace in an Age of Science and Technology.” Theology Today 59, no. 1 (2002): 6-20.
“Response to My Readers.” Techné: Research in Philosophy and Technology 6, no. 1 (2002): 76-85.
“Kinds of Pragmatism.” Techné: Research in Philosophy and Technology 7, no. 1 (2003): 18-24.
“The Headaches and Pleasures of General Education.” The Montana Professor 13 (2003): 10-15.
“Information and Inhabitation: Toward an Architecture of Disclosure and Enclosure.” Design Philosophy Papers 3, no. 2 (2004): 165-176.
“Technology and Trust.” The Bible in Transmission (2004): 11-17.
“Technology as a Cultural Force: for Alena and Griffin.” Canadian Journal of Sociology 31, no. 3 (2006): 351-360.
“The Growth of Information and the Texture of Reality.” Explorations in Media Ecology, 7, no. 4 (2008): 241-254.
“A Reply to My Critics.” Journal of Agriculture and Environmental Ethics 21, no. 1 (2008): 85-89.
“Digital Law vs. Analog Lawyers.” The Montana Lawyer 33 (2008a): 7-33.
- Borgmann discusses his work in relation to the legal profession.
“Traditional Cultural and Global Commodification.” Bulletin of Boston Theological Institute 8 (2008): 18-23.
“Does the Crisis of Global Warming Require a Spiritual Solution?” Truth and Grace: A Journal for Catholic Reflection for Southern Africa (2008b): 38-43.
“Reality and Technology.” Cambridge Journal of Economics 34, no. 1 (2010b): 27-35.
“Enclosure and Disclosure: On Content and Form In Architecture.” AI and Society 25, no. 1 (2010): 11-18.
- “…or is the question of being at once the most basic and the most concrete?” On the ambitions and responsibilities of contemporary American philosophy.” AI and Society 25, no. 1 (2010a): 19-26.
“I Miss the Hungry Years: Coping with Abundance.” The Montana Professor 21, no. 1 (2010c): 3-6.
“The Here and Now: Theory, Technology and Actuality.” Philosophy and Technology 24, no. 1 (2011a): 5-17.
“Grace and Cyberspace.” Crux 47, no. 4 (2011): 4-11.
“Response to Norm Friesen.” Techné: Research in Philosophy and Technology 15, no. 3 (2011).
“The Collision of Plausibility with Reality: Lifting the Veil of the Ethical Neutrality of Technology.” Educational Technology 52, no. 1 (2012): 40-43.
“So Who am I Really? Personal Identity in the Age of the Internet.” AI and Society 28, no. 1 (2013): 15-20.
“From Electrons to Logic Gates to Everyday Life: On the Asymmetry of Technological Devices.” Synthesis: A Journal of Science, Technology, Ethics and Policy. (2013a): 4-8.
“Knowledge and Conversation.” The Information Society 31, no. 2 (2015): 212-222.
“The Force of Wilderness within the Ubiquity of Cyberspace.” AI and Society 32, no. 2 (2015a): 261-265.
[with Rebecca Bendick] “Explanation in Philosophy and the Limits of Precision.” AI and Society 32, no. 2 (2015): 167-174.
“Being in the Anthropocene: World Appropriation in the Age of Global Warming.” Environmental Philosophy 17, no. 1 (2020): 59-74.

iii. Chapters in Edited Collections:

“Technology and Nature in Europe and America.” In International Dimensions of the Environment Crisis, edited by R.N Barrett. Westview Press, 1982.
“Philosophische Betrachtungen.” In Technikphilosophiie im Zeitalter der informationstechnik, edited by Alois Hunting and Carl Mithcam. Vieweg+Teubner Verlag, 1986.
This was Borgmann’s only German-medium publication. This chapter resulted from a German-American symposium Borgmann attended in Tarrytown, New York, in 1983.
“Republican Virtue in a Technological Society.” In Technological Change and the Transformation of America, edited by Steven Goldberg and Charles Strain. Southern Illinois University Press, 1987.
- In this article Borgmann expands on his criticisms of both conservative and liberal politics first introduced in Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life.
“Texts and Things. Holding on to Reality.” In Lifeworld and Technology, edited by Timothy Casey and Lester Embree. Center for Advanced Research in Phenomenology and University Press of America, 1990.
- The themes of this article, including the ontological distinction between the modality of texts and information, would eventually develop into Holding On to Reality.
“The Development of Technology in Eastern and Western Europe.” In Europe, America and Technology, edited by Paul Durbin. Springer, 1991.
“Artificial Realities: Centering One’s Life in an Advanced Technological Setting.” In The Presence of Feeling in Thought, edited by Bernard Den Ogden and Marcia Moen. Peter Lang Inc, 1992.
“The Postmodern Economy.” In New Worlds, New Technologies, New Issues, edited by Stephen Cutliffe. Lehigh University Press, 1992.
“The Moral Assessment of Technology.” In Democracy in a Technological Society, edited by Langdon Winner. Springer Dordrecht, 1992.
“Finding Philosophy.” In Falling in Love with Wisdom: American Philosophers Talk About their Calling, edited by David Karnos and Robert Schoemaker. Oxford University Press, 1993.
- This is a collection of autobiographical essays by American philosophers. Borgmann’s essay, therefore, describes his initial interest in philosophy and development of his career.
“The Depth of Design.” In Discovering Design: Exploration in Design Studies, edited by Richard Buchanan and Victor Margolin. University of Chicago Press, 1995a.
“The Nature of Reality and the Reality of Nature.” In Reinventing Nature?: Responses to Postmodern Deconstruction, edited by Michael Soulé and Gary Lease. Island Press, 1995c.
“Bugbee on Wilderness and Modernity.” In Wilderness and the Heart, edited by Edward Mooney. University of Georgia Press, 1999.
- Discussion of Henry Bugbee’s life and work.
“Heidegger and Ethics Beyond the Call of Duty.” In Appropriating Heidegger, edited by James Faulconer and Mark Wrathall. Cambridge University Press, 2000c.
“Reply to My Critics.” In Technology and the Good Life? Edited by Eric Higgs, Andrew Light and David Strong. University of Chicago Press, 2000b.
“Semiartifical Intelligence.” In Heidegger, Coping and Cognitive Science, edited by Mark Wrathall and Jeff Malpas. Springer Nature, 2000.
“Information Nearness and Fairness.” In The Robot in the Garden, edited by Ken Goldberg. Massachusetts Institute of Technology, 2000.
“The Transparency and Contingency of the Earth.” In Earth Matters: The Earth Sciences, Philosophy and the Claims of Community, edited by Robert Frodeman. Prentice Hall, 2000.
“Is the Internet the Solution to the Problem of Community?” In Community in the Digital Age: Philosophy and Practice, edited by Andrew Feenberg and Darin Barney. Rowman and Littlefield Publishers Inc, 2004.
“Technology.” In A Companion to Heidegger, edited by Hubert Dreyfus and Mark Wrathall. John Wiley and Sons, 2008.
“Feenberg and the Reform of Technology.” In Democratizing Technology: Andrew Feenberg’s Critical Theory of Technology, edited by Tyler Veak. SUNY Press, 2006.
- Discussion of Andrew Feenberg’s work.
“Mediating Between Science and Technology.” In Postphenomenology: A Critical Companion to Ihde, edited by Evan Selinger. SUNY Press, 2006.
“5 Questions.” In Philosophy of Technology, edited by Jan-Kyyree Berg Olsen and Evan Selinger. Automatic Press, 2007.
- This is an interview style essay where Borgmann responds to five questions posed to him about his theory of technology.
“The Destitution of Space: From Cosmic Order to Cyber Disorientation.” Nature, Landscape, and Building for Sustainability: A Harvard Design Magazine Reader, edited by William Saunders. University of Minnesota Press, 2008.
“Intelligence and the Limits of Codes.” In Switching Codes: Thinking Through Digital Technology in the Humanities and the Arts, edited by Thomas Bartscherer and Rodrick Coover. University of Chicago Press, 2011.
“The Setting of the Scene: Technological Fixes and the Design of the Good Life.” In Engineering the Climate, edited by Christopher Preston. Bloomsbury Published, 2012.
“Science, Ethics and Technology and the Challenge of Global Warming.” In Debating Science: Deliberation, Values and the Common Good, edited by Dane Scott and Blake Francis. Bloomsbury Academic, 2012.
“A Turn to Comprehension and Competence.” In Critical Making, edited by Garnet Hertz. 2012.
- This is a handwritten essay that Borgmann submitted to support this handmade book project that explores how hands-on productive work can supplement critical reflection on technology and society.
“Justice and Technology.” The Routledge Handbook of Technology, Crime and Justice, edited by M.R. McGuire and Thomas Holt. Routledge, 2017.
“The End of Technology and the Renewal of Reality.” Thinking Through Science and Technology, Philosophy, Religion and Politics in an Engineered World, edited by Glen Millers. Bloomsbury

b. Secondary Sources

Achterhuis, Hans. “Borgmann, Technology and the Good Life? and the Empirical Turn for Philosophy of Technology.” Techné: Research in Philosophy and Technology 6 no.1 (2002).
This was a special edition on Borgmann, therefore in this edition see also:
Tuman, Myron. “Holding On and Letting Go: A Review of Holding On to Reality: The Nature of Information at the Turn of the Millennium.”
Verbeek, Peter-Paul. “Devices of Engagement: On Borgmann’s Philosophy of Information and Technology.”
Antonsen, Trine and Erik Lundstead. “Borgmann and the non-neutrality of technology.” Society for Philosophy and Technology Quartlery Electronic Journal 23, no. 1 (2019): 83-103.
Boers, Arthur. Living into Focus: Choosing What Matters in the Age of Distraction. Brazos Press, 2012.
A reflection on Borgmann’s influence on various religious topics related to pastoral care and living the good life in a technological age.
Feenberg, Andrew. Critical Theory of Technology. Simon Fraser University Press, 1992.
Geerts, Robert-Jan. “Towards a Qualitative Assessment of Energy Practices.” Philosophy and Technology 30 (2017): 521-540.
Heikkero, Topi. “Material Culture and the Conditions for the Good Life: Albert Borgmann on Thinking about Ethics in Technological Culture.” In Praxiology and the Philosophy of Technology, edited by Wojciech W. Gasparski and Timo Airaksinen. Transaction Publishers: 2008.—Ethics in Technology: A Philosophical Study, edited by Lexington Books: 2012.
Hickman, Larry. “Review of Technology and the Character of Contemporary Life.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 12 (1992): 337-345.—Philosophical Tools for Technological Culture: Putting Pragmatism to Work. Indiana University Press, 2001.
Higgs, Eric, Andrew Light and David Strong eds. Technology and the Good Life? University of Chicago Press, 2000.
A collection of essays inspired by a symposium on Borgmann’s work, including “From Essentialism to Constructivism: Philosophy of Technology at the Crossroads” (2000) and a response from Borgmann, “Reply to My Critics” (2000)
Hickman, Larry. “Focaltechnics, Pragmatechnics and the Reform of Technology:” 89-105. In (Higgs 2000).
Light, Andrew. “Borgmann’s Unzeitgemässe Betrachtungen: On the Prepolotical Conditions of a Politics of Place:” 106-125. In (Higgs 2000).
Mitcham, Carl. “On Character and Technology:” 126-148. In (Higgs 2000).
Fandozzi, Phillip. “The Moving Imagine: Between Devices and Things:” 153-165. In (Higgs 2000).
Michelfelder, Diane. “Technological Ethics in a Different Voice:” 219-233. In (Higgs 2000).
Power, Michael. “Trapped in Consumption: Modern Social Structure and the Entrenchment of the Device:” 271-293. In (Higgs 2000).
Feenberg, Andrew. “From Essentialism to Constructivism: Philosophy of Technology at the Crossroads:” 294-315. In (Higgs 2000).
Mannikko, Nancy. “If a Tree Falls in the Forest: A Refutation of Technological Determinism.” Research in Philosophy and Technology 12 (1992): 213-227.
Skrbina, David. The Metaphysics of Technology. 2015.
Skrbina provides a useful introduction to the history of the philosophy of technology from the ancient era
up until the late twentieth century. See in particular, his chapter on Albert Borgmann, “Borgmann’s
‘Critical’ Metaphysics” (94-116).
Roholt, Tiger. Distracted from Meaning: A Philosophy of Smartphones. Bloomsbury Academic, 2022.
In this book, Roholt considers Borgmann’s theory of technology in relation to Susan Wolf, John Dewey and
Hubert Dreyfus to consider the question of smartphones in our contemporary lives.
Tijmes, Pieter. “Philosophy in the Service of People.” Technology in Society 21 no. 2 (1999): 175-189.
“Albert Borgmann: Technology and the Character of Everyday Life.” In American Philosophy of Technology: The Empirical Turn, edited by Hans Achterhuis. Indiana University Press 1999.
Verbeek, Peter-Paul. What Things Do. Penn State University Press, 2005
Waelbers, Katinka and Adam Briggle. “Three Schools of Thought on Freedom in Liberal, Technological Societies. Techne: Research in Philosophy and Technology 14 no. 3 (2010): 176-193.
Wood, Willian. “Not Real Enough.” Commonweal 134 no. 1 (2007).
A critical review of Borgmann’s Real American Ethics.

Author Information

Abigal Bergeron
Email: abigail.bergeron@queensu.ca
Queen’s College
United Kingdom

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy