The Applicability of Mathematics in Physics

The problem of the applicability of mathematics is the problem of explaining why mathematics plays various important roles in the natural sciences (or in nature). This problem has a long history and has been addressed by many mathematicians, scientists, and philosophers. As Mark Steiner aptly put it, “to an unappreciated degree, the history of Western philosophy is the history of attempts to understand why mathematics is applicable to Nature….” The problem is fundamental in that every philosophy of physics and every philosophy of mathematics must explain the dependency of physics on mathematics. The discussion on this problem has been especially influenced by the leading theoretical physicist, Eugene Wigner, whose 1960 paper revived and reformulated the applicability problem as “The Unreasonable Effectiveness of Mathematics.”

What seemed puzzling and “mysterious” to Wigner was the strong relationship between mathematics and physics. As Wigner noted, without mathematics there would not be such a thing as modern physics. There are many ways that physics uses mathematics. The properties of physical objects are all quantified by numbers (natural numbers, real numbers, complex numbers, and so forth). The laws are expressed in mathematical syntax such as formulas and inequalities. The physical processes are described by mathematical structures such as manifolds, vector spaces, and groups. Looking at all these aspects, one cannot resist asking: Why is mathematics so central to physics? This is the applicability problem that Wigner raised, and on which this article focuses. There is no consensus on the solution to the problem.

Statement of the Applicability Problem
The Applicability Problem as a Pseudo-Problem
1. The Applicability Problem and Other Sciences
2. Ineffectiveness of Mathematics in Physics
Ontological Solutions to the Problem
Epistemic Solutions to The Problem
References and Further Reading

1. Statement of the Applicability Problem

a. Introducing the Problem

The relationship between mathematics and modern physics has turned out to be enduring, important, and strong. It is not only the strength of this relationship but also its significance that has created a sense of wonder among scholars. What seems to be puzzling is the underlying distinctness between the relata of this relationship. Physics is the study of inanimate nature and the discovery of its laws, or symmetries, or models. Mathematics is the study of abstract concepts and structures, which seem to be removed from the empirical study of nature. How is it then that there is such a strong and long-lasting relationship?

The philosophical problem of the applicability of mathematics arises from a distinctness thesis. For some, the distinctness is ontological: mathematical objects belong to a different reality than physical objects. Physical objects are said to be causal and spatiotemporal. Mathematical objects, on the other hand, stand outside the flow of time and causality. How are these two realms related to each other? Why is it that knowledge about the abstract realm of mathematics proves to be effective in generating knowledge about the world of concrete physical phenomena?

Mathematics is also distinct from physics in its methodology. The research in mathematics is said to be driven by internal mathematical standards, such as rigor, mathematical beauty, and elegance. On this conception, mathematics is: (1) an autonomous discipline, (2) with its internal norms such as rigor, generality, consistency, mathematical beauty (notoriously, applicability is not among them), and (3) whose objects of study are abstract. Physics, on the other hand, is governed by standards such as empirical adequacy and producing empirically testable results. Why is it that a practice that is guided by rigor, elegance, simplicity, and formal beauty proves successful in an area that is governed by empirical standards (Islami & Wiltsche 2020)?

Given this distinctness, the applicability problem is the problem of explaining why mathematics is effective and useful for describing, explaining, and predicting the kinds of physical phenomena with which science is concerned. The dependency of physics on mathematics can easily be seen in the early 21^st century academy, where every physics class requires many mathematics classes as prerequisites. To some extent, a physics statement (such as a physical law) is not complete until it is put into a mathematical language. One needs the correct differential equation, the exact function, or the right formula. Otherwise, it is not physics.

Wigner and many other prominent scientists highlighted the distinctness and a sense of wonder and puzzlement over the applicability:

Albert Einstein wrote:

At this point an enigma presents itself, which in all ages has agitated inquiring minds. How can it be that mathematics, being after all a product of human thought which is independent of experience, is so admirably appropriate to the objects of reality? Is human reason, then, without experience, merely by taking thought, able to fathom the properties of real things? (Einstein 1921)

Paul Dirac described the situation as follows:

[T]he mathematician plays a game in which he himself invents the rules while the physicist plays a game in which the rules are provided by Nature, but as time goes on it becomes increasingly evident that the rules which the mathematician finds interesting are the same as those which Nature has chosen. It is difficult to predict what the result of all this will be. (Dirac 1939)

David Hilbert wrote:

We are confronted with the peculiar fact that matter seems to comply well and truly to the formalism of mathematics. There arises an unforeseen unison of being and thinking, which for the present we have to accept like a miracle. (Hilbert 1919)

In Wigner’s important paper, he wrote:

The miracle of the appropriateness of the language of mathematics for the formulation of the laws of physics is a wonderful gift which we neither understand nor deserve. We should be grateful for it and hope that it will remain valid in future research and that it will extend, for better or for worse, to our pleasure, even though perhaps also to our bafflement, to wide branches of learning. (Wigner 1960, p. 237)

[T]he enormous usefulness of mathematics in the natural sciences is something bordering on the mysterious and there is no rational explanation for it. (Wigner 1960, p. 223)

It is difficult to avoid the impression that a miracle confronts us here, quite comparable in its striking nature to the miracle that the human mind can string a thousand arguments together without getting itself into contradictions, or to the two miracles of the existence of laws of nature and of the human mind’s capacity to divine them. (Wigner 1960, p. 229)

In non-Western traditions, the question of the applicability of mathematics and the status of its entities also has a long history. In the Persian and Islamic worlds, for instance, the question of the relationship between mathematics and astronomy was subject to heated debates. See (Zarepour 2022).

b. Wigner’s Formulation of the Problem

In Wigner’s view, the differences between mathematics and physics are so fundamental that there is no way to bridge the gap between them and thus to explain the applicability of mathematics. To see why, look at how he defined mathematics and physics.

Wigner defined mathematics as the “science of skillful operations with concepts and rules invented for just this purpose” (Wigner 1960). The emphasis here is on the invention of mathematical concepts on the basis of their manipulability and formal beauty without paying attention to their applicability.

As G.H. Hardy wrote:

The mathematician’s patterns, like the painter’s or the poet’s, must be beautiful; the ideas, like the colors or the words, must fit together in a harmonious way. Beauty is the first test: there is no permanent place in the world for ugly mathematics. (Hardy 1940, p. 85)

Bertrand Russell also emphasized the role of beauty in mathematics when he wrote:

Mathematics, rightly viewed, possesses not only truth, but supreme beauty, cold and austere, like that of sculpture, without appeal to any part of our weaker nature, without the gorgeous trappings of painting or music, yet sublimely pure, and capable of a stern perfection such as only the greatest art can show. The true spirit of delight, the exaltation, the sense of being more than Man, which is the touchstone of the highest excellence, is to be found in mathematics as surely as in poetry. (Also quoted in Wigner 1960)

Wigner was an advocate of the Hilbert School of formalism, according to which mathematics is understood to be a game of meaningless symbols (Ferreiros 2017). While mathematicians, in Wigner’s view, are concerned with beautiful and manipulable patterns, physicists have a different objective: “The physicist, unlike the mathematician, is interested in inanimate nature and in discovering ‘regularities’ that exist among the natural phenomena” (Wigner 1960).

Given this distinctness, what seems to be puzzling is that virtually every law of physics is formulated mathematically: the second law of motion in classical mechanics is formulated using the second derivative of position with respect to time; the axioms of quantum mechanics are formulated using a complex Hilbert space, where the states are defined as vectors in Hilbert space and the observables are self-adjoint operators on these Hilbert spaces; relativity theory is formulated using smooth manifolds. These are just a few instances of the general phenomena of the successful use of mathematical concepts in physical theories.

The situation, Wigner claimed, is like “a man who was provided with a bunch of keys and who, having to open several doors in succession, always hit on the right key on the first or second trial” (Wigner 1960). In this analogy, “keys” refers to mathematical concepts, and locks are regularities in the natural phenomena.

Mark Steiner (Steiner 1998, p. 46) summarized Wigner’s argument as follows:

(1) Mathematical concepts arise from the aesthetic impulse in humans.

(2) It is unreasonable to expect that what arises from the aesthetic impulse in humans should be significantly effective in physics.

(3) Nevertheless, a significant number of these concepts are significantly effective in physics.

(4) Hence, mathematical concepts are unreasonably effective in physics.

c. Examples of Applicability

There are numerous examples of the applicability of mathematics discussed by scholars, beginning with the cases raised by Wigner in his 1960 paper. In some cases, mathematics is used “merely as a tool” to help us calculate the consequences of a law in a particular situation. More interesting is where mathematics plays a more “sovereign role” in the very formulation of the laws of physics, as mentioned above.

The first example is the case of planetary motion. One must see this from a historical perspective. The Greek geometer Apollonius lived prior to 200 BCE and studied the mathematical shapes that occur when a cone is intersected with a flat plane. Such intersections are called conic sections. He was able to describe circles, ellipses, parabolas, and hyperbolas using such methods. In his book, he stated about 400 theorems concerning the different properties of conic sections. Eighteen hundred years after Apollonius lived, Johannes Kepler was trying to figure out how to make sense of Copernicus’s radical new idea of having the sun in the center of the galaxy with the planets going around it. He realized that the planets traveled around in ellipses and not circles. Kepler was able to determine properties of planetary motion by reading a book that was almost two millennia old. An historian of science, William Whewell, wrote that “If the Greeks had not cultivated conic sections, Kepler could not have superseded Ptolemy” (Whewell 1837, p. vi). How is it possible that the abstract writings of an ancient Greek mathematician could help explain the motion of the planets? Along the same lines, the parabolas of Apollonius also helped Newton explain the motion of projectiles flying through space.

The law of freely falling bodies was established as a result of experiments which cannot be considered very accurate by human standards. Newton brought the case of freely falling bodies together with the motion of the moon. He realized that “the parabola of the thrown rock’s path on the earth and the circle of the moon’s path in the sky are particular cases of the same mathematical object of an ellipse” (Wigner 1960). On the basis of these approximate observations and numerical coincidences, he postulated the universal law of gravitation. This law is written in the language of mathematics, using the second derivative, and the law is known to be accurate to less than one ten thousandth of a percent.

Another example that Wigner discussed is the use of matrices in quantum mechanics. On the basis of experimental data from the hydrogen atom, Heisenberg came up with a form of basic quantum mechanics. When Max Born read Heisenberg’s paper, he realized that what Heisenberg had been working with was formally identical with the rules of computation for matrices, which had been established before by mathematicians. Born, Jordan, and Heisenberg then proposed to replace the position and momentum variables of the equations of classical mechanics with matrices. They applied the rules of matrix mechanics to a few highly idealized problems. At that time, there was no reason to think that one could apply these results to more realistic and complex cases such as the helium atom. The agreement of the calculations with experiments came as a pleasant surprise. The success of matrix mechanics is even more surprising given the fact that matrices were already known to mathematicians decades before the formulation of quantum mechanics (Wigner 1960).

There are—of course—many other examples of the applicability of mathematics that Wigner did not mention. Arithmetical operations such as addition and multiplication are an example of the basic use of mathematics in everyday life, rather than just physics. When there is a collection of distinct objects and another collection of other distinct objects, then when they are combined, there is a collection x + y of distinct objects. It is to be noted that the addition operation satisfies commutativity and associativity, that is:

x + y = y + x and (x + y) + z = x + (y + z)

which is also satisfied by grouping physical objects. In case of multiplication, if there are boxes, and each box contains objects, then there is a total of x × y objects. Again, the rules of arithmetic, such as distributivity, that is:

x × (y + z) = (x × y) + (x × z)

are satisfied by collections of physical objects.

A more sophisticated use of mathematics is the use of differential and integral calculus to describe accelerated motion. Isaac Newton and Gottfried Leibniz invented independent versions of calculus so that they can describe the way physical objects interact. To solve problems in physics, one needs a fairly advanced knowledge of calculus. Calculus is used to calculate the times and speed of balls rolling down ramps and cannon balls making parabolas in the air. This goes on to multidimensional vector calculus which is applied to all types of physical phenomena. Differential equations permit the physicist to calculate many more physical phenomena.

Basic arithmetic and its applications were both noticed simultaneously. Differential calculus was invented by Newton and Leibniz to be applied to understand real world physics. The applicability problem becomes much more interesting when the theoretical mathematics is formulated first–before the applied mathematics, such as in the case of matrices and complex numbers. While algebraists in the 16th century came up with imaginary quantities in order to solve cubic equations, these strange and “nonsensical” quantities, as they were called, found their ways to the most fundamental equations of physics, in electromagnetism and quantum mechanics (Islami 2018).

The two major revolutionary theories of the twentieth century, relativity theory and quantum theory, are replete with examples of the “unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics” as this phenomenon has come to be known. When Albert Einstein was interested in describing the curved spacetime which is central to the general theory of relativity, a friend, Marcel Grossmann, introduced him to non-Euclidean geometries (Pais, 1982, p. 22). Non-Euclidean geometries were introduced decades earlier as ways to replace the fifth postulate of Euclidean geometry—the parallel postulate—with its negation. It seems strange that an intellectual curiosity about the fifth postulate of geometry proves to be so helpful in understanding the universe at-large.

Major aspects of quantum theory are described by previously existing mathematical structures and theorems: (1) As discussed, imaginary quantities were first introduced in the 16th century but nevertheless played a central role in quantum theory. (2) Werner Heisenberg used matrices to describe quantum phenomena, even though matrices were known to mathematicians well before quantum mechanics was known to physicists (Sudbery 1986).

Algebraic topology was originally formed to classify and categorize topological spaces. In the early 21st century, the tools of algebraic topology were used in the study of string theory. This relationship is so strong that some physicists who disparage string theory have taken it to be “just math” (Smolin 2006).

One of the most useful mathematical structures in all of physics is Évariste Galois’s notion of a group. The structure was invented in the beginning of the 19th century to describe the symmetries of polynomial equations. It was soon realized that this notion can describe any type of symmetry, and it has become central in all of physics, especially throughout quantum mechanics and specifically in particle physics. What was once taught only in advanced classes regarding obscure polynomial equations is a prerequisite for much of theoretical physics. The physicist Hermann Weyl wrote the following about the discovery of the notion of a group:

Galois’ ideas, […] are contained in a farewell letter written to a friend on the eve of his death, which he met in a silly duel at the age of twenty-one. This letter, if judged by the novelty and profundity of ideas it contains, is perhaps the most substantial piece of writing in the whole literature of mankind. (Weyl, 1952, p. 138)

This list can be extended indefinitely. The main point is that in these cases, mathematics, invented for many different reasons, is extremely applicable to physical phenomena. Why should this be?

2. The Applicability Problem as a Pseudo-Problem

a. The Applicability Problem and Other Sciences

In response to the applicability problem, some scholars have pointed out the limitations of the use of mathematics in other sciences, which makes them convinced that Wigner’s sense of mystery is at best unjustified. Velupillai argues for the unreasonable ineffectiveness of mathematics in economics (Velupillai 2005). Longo and Montévil argue for the reasonable ineffectiveness of mathematics in biology (Longo and Montévil 2016). The mathematician, Israel M. Gelfand is often quoted as saying:

There is only one thing which is more unreasonable than the unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics in physics, and this is the unreasonable ineffectiveness of mathematics in biology.

Hamming argues for the reasonable and limited effectiveness of mathematics in everyday life and engineering (Hamming 1980, Islami 2022). The ineffectiveness is even more pronounced in sociology, psychology, and anthropology.

With these limitations in mind, the problem of the unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics is partially answered. If Velupillai, Longo, Gelfand and other commentators are right, then mathematics is not so effective in the natural sciences, broadly construed. Rather, it is mostly effective in modern theoretical physics. Moreover, when discussing physics, there are also some limitations to the applicability of mathematics.

b. Ineffectiveness of Mathematics in Physics

Perhaps the effectiveness of mathematics in other sciences and in physical phenomena is too much to ask for. Wigner claimed to address the unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics in the “natural sciences.” However, the title is a bit misleading (Islami 2017). The body of the paper is entirely focused on the applicability of mathematics in modern physics. And even there, mathematics fails to be perfectly suited.

There are numerous examples of such limitations (for example, Kline 1980), but this article discusses only two: the three-body problem in classical physics and the measurement problem in quantum mechanics.

In a sense, this section contrasts with Section 1c. There, the article listed many examples of physical phenomena that are described by mathematics. The following are a few failure cases of the use of mathematics in physics.

Starting with classical mechanics, take the simple idea from Isaac Newton that two objects with masses m and m’ which are separated by a distance of r are attracted to each other by a force given by

F = Gmm’/r².

This mathematical law will give the correct answer only under perfect conditions. This means objects are measured from their exact centers; the objects are perfectly spherical, exactly homogeneous; neither object has any electrical charge; they are far away from any third object that would influence them; they are large enough so that no quantum mechanical phenomena is active, small enough so that no general relativity phenomena are active, and nothing else interferes. These requirements severely restrict the number of phenomena described by the rule. In order to use this rule, physicists make many idealizations which are not really true. In short, this mathematical formula that is at the center of classical mechanics is not very applicable.

This is evident from examining the requirement that there is no third object near the two objects. While Isaac Newton gave us a powerful mathematical formula to describe the attractive forces of two bodies, mathematics has not provided a simple formula for three bodies. How do three objects interact with each other? This is called the three-body problem, and it cannot be solved. The three-body problem is an early, though long unrecognized, example of chaos. Chaos theory is replete with physical problems for which mathematics is of no help (Diacu and Holmes 1996). A double pendulum is one of the simplest examples of a chaotic system. This is a string which connects to a body which connects to another string and another body. Those two bodies and the Earth combine to form three bodies. While its actions are totally deterministic, it is not predictable. In contrast, a single pendulum is totally predictable. The Moon, Sun and Earth form a three-body problem. The unpredictability of this three-body problem manifests itself by the fact that there is no exact length of a lunar month. On average it is about 29.5 days but there is no way to exactly predict how long each month will be (Peale 2023).

One can go on and ask about more than three bodies. The more complicated n-body problem is of course unsolvable. There are no formulas to tell us how three particles interact and there are definitely no simple formulas to tell us about the interactions within the entire universe.

Along the same lines, a larger part of the work of physicists is constituted by differential equations. All types of problems in physics are described by differential equations. However, solutions to the vast majority of differential equations are unavailable. One might be able to describe the problem with mathematics, but not easily.

The measurement problem is another part of physics for which mathematics is of no help. Quantum mechanics is considered the most successful theory ever formulated. It is proclaimed to be correct up to the proverbial fourteenth decimal place. But there is a nagging lacuna concerning the applicability of mathematics to quantum mechanics. When a measurement is made in quantum mechanics, the Born rule tells us that the results are given probabilistically and not deterministically. In other words, quantum mechanics only offers a probability distribution rather than an exact answer. The theory that describes every interaction besides gravity is probabilistic and not deterministic. There are no mathematical formulas to tell us how likely it is that a particle will actually collapse (fission). One can defend mathematics by saying that the inherent nature of the physical universe is probabilistic, and not deterministic. Therefore, it simply is not a problem that mathematics fails to predict the future.

Along the same lines, the fields of thermodynamics and statistical mechanics also only give probabilistic results. The universe is far more complicated than the mathematics of the early 21^st century possess so there are no known ways to solve such problems.

Sabine Hossenfelder has an interesting argument about the role of mathematics in physics. She says that sometimes mathematics leads physics astray (Hossenfelder, 2018). There are other philosophers such as Nancy Cartwright (Cartwright 1983) and Mark Wilson (Wilson 2000) who have critiqued the role of mathematics in applied physics.

Given these examples of where mathematics does not easily apply to physics, Wigner’s problem doesn’t seem so mysterious. In vast parts of physics, mathematics is, in fact, not so helpful. The mystery comes about only if one focuses on those parts of physics which mathematics helps.

3. Ontological Solutions to the Problem

The article has outlined the limitations of mathematics in other sciences and even in physics. With those limitations in mind, the applicability problem becomes more nuanced. Why is it that mathematics is so well-suited for the parts of physics where it is effective? In other words, why does mathematics work where it does work? Moreover, mathematics seems to be effective in the most fundamental parts of physics. The standard model of particle physics and basic general relativity are described by mathematical structures. The nuanced question of the applicability of mathematics is: why is mathematics so effective in the most fundamental theories of physics?

The next few sections describe some of the solutions given to this more subtle and focused question. The list is not by any means exhaustive.

a. Classical Pythagoreanism and Platonism

One of the first schools of thought to deal with the relationship between mathematics and the physical world, in the Western tradition, was the Pythagoreans who were active from the 6th century BC. They believed that numbers were somehow imbued with the divine. These numbers create physical objects and express the harmony of existence. Pythagoreans even incorporated some aspects of aesthetics in their philosophy by stating relationships between lengths of strings and sounds. Western musical scales come from these ideas.

For the Pythagoreans, the applicability of mathematics in natural sciences is simple. Since the universe is made out of numbers, it makes sense the physical world is controlled by mathematics. They believed that with pure thought about abstract numbers, one can come to understand the physical world. This unseen, pure realm cannot be accessed by the physical senses. The idea of such a pure realm came to have a deep and profound influence on Western philosophy and religion.

Platonism took the Pythagorean idea of the pure realm as its central dogma. To Platonists, the physical world was no longer imbued with the divine. Rather, the physical universe was simply a bad imitation of the perfect realm. This realm contains all numbers and all the relationships between numbers. In fact, it contains all of mathematics that ever existed and ever will exist. This Platonic heaven also contains all true physical laws that ever existed and perfect notions of truth, justice, and beauty. Their main point is to accept that the physical world is unimportant, and the only true existence is the Platonic realm accessed through the human mind.

Galileo perhaps provided the most famous “solution” to the applicability problem, following a version of Platonism. According to Galileo, the universe is written in a mathematical language so it should not be a surprise that empirical investigation of the universe (in physics for instance) is filled with mathematical statements:

Philosophy is written in that great book which continually lies open before us (I mean the Universe). But one cannot understand this book until one has learned to understand the language and to know the letters in which it is written. It is written in the language of mathematics, and the letters are triangles, circles and other geometric figures. Without these means it is impossible for mankind to understand a single word; without these means there is only vain stumbling in a dark labyrinth (Galileo 1623, p. 171).

According to Galileo, while the universe is fundamentally mathematical, senses mask the mathematical essence of the universe. So, he divided the qualities of the objects into two categories: primary and secondary. The primary qualities, such as size and shape, are mathematical while the secondary qualities such as color, taste and scent are not. But one should not be deceived by the secondary qualities into forgetting the mathematical essence of the universe. In Galileo’s own immutable words:

Whenever I conceive any … corporeal substance, I immediately … think of it as … having this or that shape; as being large or small … and in some specific place at any given time; as being in motion or at rest; as touching or not touching some other body; and as being one in number, or few, or many. From these conditions I cannot separate such a substance by any stretch of my imagination. But that it must be white or red, bitter or sweet, noisy or silent, and of sweet or foul odor, my mind does not feel compelled … Without the senses … reason … would probably never arrive at qualities like these. Hence I think that tastes, odors, colors, and so on are no more than mere names so far as the object in which we place them is concerned, and that they reside only in the consciousness. Hence if the living creature were removed, all these qualities would be … annihilated (Galilei 1957, p.274).

One can think of Galileo as an advocate of Platonism, according to which the true reality is perfect and mathematical, but sensory experience gives us an imperfect image of this otherwise perfect reality. The same idea is almost ubiquitous in anti-Aristotelian natural philosophy, and it is formulated by Bacon (1620) in Novum Organon and by Descartes in The World (ca.1630) and Principles (1644). Descartes surely took it from Galileo.

b. Modern Platonism

Mathematical Platonists posit that mathematical entities exist in an independent Platonic realm. According to this view, mathematical objects are abstract and independent from thoughts, language and practices. One motivation behind adopting Platonism is the “Quine-Putnam indispensability argument” according to which, since mathematics is indispensable in physics, a commitment to both the existence of mathematical and physical entities is required. In other words, a realist commitment to the existence of objects described by theories of physics leads to a realist commitment to the existence of mathematical objects. See, for example, (Colyvan 2001), (Maddy, 1990), and (Balaguer, 1998). For a critical examination of the indispensability argument, see Chapter 8 of (Bueno and French 2018). See also (Soto, 2019), and (Pincock, 2007).

One of the greatest mathematical physicists of the 20^th Century, Roger Penrose, adopts a modern version of Platonism. According to him, there exists three worlds: a Platonic world, a physical world, and a mental world. While a typical Platonist has to explain how a small part of the Platonic world controls the physical world, Penrose furthermore has to deal with how a small part of the physical world creates a sentient person with a mental world. He also has to explain how a small part of the mental world can create or perceive the Platonic world. Penrose admits that each of these connections are somewhat mysterious, but he defends the entire system as being the correct way to understand the universe (Penrose 1994, s.8.7).

The applicability problem for the Platonist is solved by positing that the perfect laws of physics are stated by perfect mathematics which all exist in the Platonic realm. While it is important to perform experiments in the physical universe, one must be well versed in the pure mathematics of the Platonic realm to be able to understand the physical universe.

While Platonists deal with the applicability problem by saying that the timeless physical laws are perfectly expressed by the timeless mathematical ideas contained in the same realm, it is still not clear how they relate to each other. Moreover, there are many questions left unanswered. How does one access this Platonic realm? Why is it that the regularities in the world have a mathematical formulation? What about a mathematical theory that was shown to be false or not always true? Is such a theory contained in the Platonic realm? See (Field, 1980) and (Field, 1989).

c. Modern Pythagoreanism

Some offer a version of Pythagoreanism as a solution to the applicability problem. The idea is that the universe is a mathematical structure and that people live in a mathematical universe. Viewed in this way, it had to be the case that all laws of physics are written in the language of mathematics. Hence, there is no mystery to the applicability of mathematics in physics.

Several contemporary scientists advocate a version of Pythagoreanism. The cosmologist Max Tegmark notes that as science progresses, we learn that more and more aspects of the physical universe are described by mathematical structures. Even subatomic particles, which compose all physical matter, are described by irreducible representations of some symmetry groups. However, Tegmark takes this one step further. He posits that physical reality is not only described by mathematical structures, but physical reality is an all-encompassing mathematical structure, which he calls the mathematical universe hypothesis. In other words, subatomic particles are not described by irreducible representations of symmetry groups, but subatomic particles are irreducible representations of groups. The only entities which exist are mathematical. Even observers of the physical universe are simply complex mathematical structures. All of the trees, frogs and tables that can be seen are an illusion. They are simply one way that a mathematical structure views another structure (Tegmark 2008, 2014).

From Tegmark’s point of view, the applicability of mathematics to physics is reasonable. Mathematics is applicable to the physical world because the physical world is simply mathematical structures that unfold in mathematical ways. Tegmark writes of his form of Pythagoreanism that “it explains the utility of mathematics for describing the physical world as a natural consequence of the fact that the latter is a mathematical structure, and we are simply uncovering this bit by bit” (Tegmark 2008).

More radical than saying that the entire universe is made of mathematical structures is to say that the entire multiverse is described by a single mathematical structure. Sean Carroll describes the modern notion of Hugh Everett’s multiverse theory in this way (Carroll, 2019). Rather than saying that a new universe pops into existence every time a quantum measurement is made, he describes there being one giant quantum wave function of the multiverse. This single wave function describes the universe from the beginning of time to the end of time. When a measurement is made, different parts of the single wave function collapse. This and all theories of the multiverse are almost beyond any imagination. It is important to note that no scientific experiment can show that this theory is false. Nevertheless, the existence of the single mathematical structure of the wave function would explain why math is so useful in describing physical phenomena.

4. Epistemic Solutions to The Problem

Although ontological solutions present us with claims about the kind of worlds there are, epistemic solutions focus on the kind of cognition and knowledge humans have in relation to physics and mathematics.

a. Transcendental Solutions

According to Kant’s transcendental idealism, cognition is the result of the work of human faculties of sensibility and understanding. Sensibility is a passive or receptive capacity to be affected by objects of the world, while understanding organizes this received data into coherent concepts and judgments. The only way that one could grasp an intelligible world is through sensibility.

In Kant’s view, mathematics, particularly geometry and arithmetic, is grounded in the a priori intuitions of space and time. These intuitions provide the necessary framework for organizing sensory experience, allowing us to cognize the world. Thus, mathematical concepts like geometric shapes and numerical relationships are not merely reflections of empirical reality but are fundamental to a mode of cognition.

Given this conception of mathematics and physics, the applicability of mathematics to modern physics is possible because both disciplines share this common foundation in the structure of human cognition. Through Kant’s transcendental solution, mathematics is not seen as an arbitrary tool imposed onto the world but as a study of aspects of human cognition that enable us to grasp the order and regularity of the universe. See (Ryckman, 2023) and (Toretti, 1990).

Scientists, by employing mathematical principles, extend the reach of understanding beyond immediate sensory experience, enabling them to uncover regularities of nature.

b. Laws of Physics and Invariance Principles

A good starting point for an epistemic solution to the applicability problem is by looking at how mathematics is used in modern theoretical physics. In other words, one can ask oneself, what is modern physics and how can it be distinguished from Aristotelian physics which was not mathematical?

Modern physics focuses on regularities that exist among the phenomena and their mathematical formulation. Since the world is a very complex place, some physicists have long given up the ideal of “explaining” nature. The great success of modern physics, as Wigner reminded us, is in restricting its objective. Nature, as Roman puts it, just is. “It cannot be ‘explained’, at least not as far as science is concerned. Existence is a primary category, including, by the way, ourselves, too” (Roman 2004, p. 2).

Modern physicists focus on the discovery of regularities in the behavior of inanimate objects. What has made the discovery of these regularities and their mathematical formulation possible is a division that physicists have used between initial conditions and regularities. Regularities are the time evolution of a system whereas initial conditions are the state of the system at the outset. While the regularities can be formulated using mathematics, initial conditions are the domain of accidental and unordered. Wigner wrote:

Man, has, therefore devised an artifice that permits the complicated nature of the world to be blamed on something which is called accidental and thus permits him to abstract a domain in which simple laws can be found. The complications are called initial conditions, the domain of regularities, laws of nature. Unnatural as this division of the world structure may appear from a detached point of view, and probable though that the possibility of such a division has its own limits, the underlying abstraction is probably one of the most fruitful ones that human mind has made (Wigner 1949, p. 3).

This division is a condition for the possibility of formulating mathematical laws of nature. It is a condition for the possibility of modern mathematical physics. The contemporary physicist, Steven Weinberg, echoed Wigner’s remarks:

In modern quantum mechanics as well as in Newtonian mechanics there is a clear separation between the conditions that tell us the initial state of a system (whether the system is the whole universe, or just a part of it), and the laws that govern its subsequent evolution. (Weinberg 1992, p. 34)

Similarly, Frank Wilczek wrote:

Indeed, classical physics teaches us that the size of planetary orbits is not the sort of thing we should aspire to predict. It makes a sharp distinction between the basic laws, which govern the evolution of systems in time, and are expected to be simple, and the initial conditions, which must be given from outside. The equations of classical physics can be applied to any number of different types of solar system, having different sizes and shapes. There is nothing in Newton’s laws of gravity and mechanics, nor for that matter in the other pillar of classical physics, Maxwell’s electrodynamics, that could serve to fix a definite size. (Wilczek 1999, p. 303)

What, in turn, makes possible the division between regularities and initial conditions are invariance or symmetry principles. The invariance with respect to transformations (changes) in space and time are examples of invariance principles. Without these invariances, one could not assume that the result of these experiments done in a particular lab, at a particular time, holds universally. Had it been the case that regularities change from one place (time) to another, and from one time to the next, it would be impossible to test the accuracy of laws.

Invariance principles can be understood as laws of laws of nature: regularities that exist among the laws. They are conditions for the possibility of modern physics. In a nutshell, the invariance principles give laws their universality which is a feature that makes their mathematical formulation possible. See Chapter 9 of (Bueno and French, 2018), Chapter 1 of (Pincock 2012), and (Soto and Bueno 2019).

Noticing the particular structure of modern physics helps with solving the applicability problem by answering the question of what it is about modern physics that makes a mathematical formulation of its laws possible. Hermann Weyl argued that mathematics is a science that is concerned with the study of most general relations that exist among objects, and that invariance principles of physics furnish the use of such general relations (Islami 2017). Once this has been made clear, one can look at the co-constitution of mathematics and physics and their evolving and dynamic relationship (Wiltsche-Islami 2020).

Moreover, it is not only mathematics that has led to a particular constitution of physical concepts and relations but also physics has changed mathematics drastically (See Levy-Leblond 1992, Lützen 2011, Gingras 2001). This connects closely to the point about the physical origins of mathematics.

c. Physical Origins of Mathematical Concepts

An epistemic solution to the applicability problem is that mathematics was formulated by observing the physical universe. Human beings constructed mathematical notions by seeing them at work in the physical universe. People learn addition by looking at the way ensembles are combined. People learn calculus by looking at accelerating bodies. People learn about symmetries by seeing physical transformations of objects (Such ideas can be found in many papers of the Mickens 1990 collection of papers on the unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics).

The mathematician Richard Hamming, in his article published twenty years after Wigner’s 1960 contribution, presents what he considered to be partial explanations for the unreasonable effectiveness of mathematics.:

(1) People see what they look for. After all, no one should be surprised to see the whole world blueish if one has blue glasses on her eyes.

(2) People select the kind of mathematics to use. That is, when the mathematical tools that are chosen are not adequate in a particular case, people choose a different kind, such as vectors instead of scalars.

(3) Science in fact answers comparatively few problems. It of course does not say much about long-asked questions about God, Justice, Beauty, Truth and so on.

(4) The evolution of man has provided the model. One can think about objects especially the macroscopic ones, an ability that surely has had survival value (Hamming 1980).

In general, Hamming’s claim is that the number system that has been developed through abstraction, generalization, increased simplicity and aesthetic reasons (all internal to mathematics) provides us with a system that “is unreasonably effective even in mathematics itself.” Hamming asks, how is it that one can apply numbers to the concepts of physical objects? More precisely, what is it about the world that makes the abstraction of numbers possible?

His response is that the universe is constituted in such a way that abstractions of this sort are possible. Were the bodies that one attempts to count not reasonably stable, one would not be able to abstract numbers and arithmetic would lose its application. That is, objects that are important in everyday life and in science, to which arithmetic applies, remain the same under a group of translations in space and time.

The number of coins in my pocket, as Steiner pointed out, remains the same no matter where I am or what time of the day, month, or year it is (Steiner 1998). The number of coins remains the same, regardless of whether I put some nuts in my pocket or take out my keys. All countable objects “stay constant” for long enough to be counted.

What makes addition useful is that gathering or assembling objects preserves their stable existence. The operation of addition is also invariant under translations in time and space. The case of multiplication is similar. Given those facts, Hamming claims there is nothing unexpected and mysterious about the usefulness of counting, addition and multiplication. One can easily come up with requirements that a quantity needs to satisfy in order for it to have an “additive structure,” such that the operation of addition can be used with respect to it.

d. Mathematics as the Science of Symmetry

Yanofsky and Zelcer (2016) and Yanofsky (2016) argue for a novel solution to the applicability problem that uses symmetry in a fundamental way. In order to understand this, one must go back and understand how symmetry works in modern physics. With that in hand, Yanofsky and Zelcer’s definition of mathematics can be understood. Finally, symmetry can be understood as the unifying factor in the relationship between physics and mathematics.

One must understand a revolution that Albert Einstein started with his formulation of special relativity, which brought to light the fundamental role of symmetries in physics. Prior to Einstein’s work, symmetries were understood to be the mere consequences of the laws of physics, for example Galilean relativity was seen as the consequence of the laws of motion in Newton’s Principia. With Einstein’s work, symmetries came to be the cornerstone of laws of physics and conditions that each law had to meet.

The real importance of symmetry came when Einstein formulated the laws of special relativity. Prior to him, one first found a law of nature and then found its symmetries. In contrast, Einstein used the symmetries to discover the laws. In order to find the laws of special relativity, he posited that the laws must be the same for a stationary observer and an observer moving close to the speed of light. Given these presuppositions, Einstein went on to formulate the equations that describe special relativity. This was revolutionary. Einstein had realized that symmetries are the defining characteristics of laws of physics. In summary, before Einstein, physicists would say “a physical law satisfies symmetries.” After Einstein, physicists said “Whatever satisfies symmetries is a physical law.” See for example (Icke 1995) or (Schumm 2004).

In 1918, Emmy Noether showed that symmetry is even more central to physics. She proved a celebrated theorem that connected symmetry to conservation laws that permeate physics. The theorem states that for every symmetry of a certain type there exists a conservation law and vice versa. For example, the fact that the laws of physics are invariant with respect to translations in space corresponds to conservation of linear momentum. Time invariance corresponds to conservation of energy. Orientation invariance corresponds to conservation of angular momentum. Equipped with the understanding given by Einstein and Noether of the centrality of symmetry, physicists have been searching for novel and different types of symmetries in order to find new laws of physics.

After the work of Einstein and Noether, much of theoretical physics became about finding symmetries. As the Nobel prize winning physicist David Gross wrote, “in the latter half of the 20th century symmetry has been the dominant concept in the exploration and formulation of the fundamental laws of physics” (Gross 1996). This trend is particularly strong in particle physics and the standard model. The symmetries are represented by certain mathematical groups, and one studies the particles by studying the representations of those groups in vector spaces.

The laws of physics have another symmetry that is so obvious it has hardly been articulated. Every law of physics concerns types of objects. For example, some laws are about fermions. Some laws are about strings. Some laws are about all subatomic particles. Classical mechanics is about macroscopic objects that are not moving close to the speed of light. Special relativity theory concerns objects that can even be moving close to the speed of light. General relativity deals with objects that might be accelerating. There are many laws that deal with ideal gasses. For every law, one calls the type of physical objects that it is concerned with, its “domain of applicability.” With such a class of objects, one then formulates a “symmetry of applicability.” This says that one can swap any element in the domain of applicability for another element in the domain of applicability and after making the corresponding changes, the law gives the correct result. This is just another way of saying that the law applies to all the elements of the domain of applicability without exception.

Yanofsky and Zelcer take this revolutionary way of looking at physics to the world of mathematical structures. Their conception of mathematics is firmly in the nominalistic camp. The following question is posed and answered: of all the thoughts, how does one demarcate mathematical thoughts? Just as physics is defined as those phenomena that satisfy certain symmetries, they define mathematics as those thoughts which satisfy certain types of symmetries.

When communicating mathematics, one makes statements, and these statements are about certain structures or ideas. When a mathematician says “let n be a natural number…” or “let every closed curve be,…” or “the following is true for all quasi triangular coassociative quantum groups…., in all these cases, the statement is describing a “domain of discourse.” The variable can be any element in the domain of discourse.

A mathematical statement has a form of symmetry associated with it and its domain of discourse. Yanofsky and Zelcer call this “symmetry of semantics.” It states that the statement is true for one element of the domain of discourse if and only if the statement is true after swapping the element for any other element. In other words, the statement is invariant with respect to changing the element of the domain of discourse. The logician will recognize this requirement as saying that mathematical statements are valid for all elements of the domain of discourse. However, by stating validity as a form of symmetry, Yanofsky and Zelcer are making an analogy with other forms of symmetry. In particular, symmetry of semantics is very similar to symmetry of applicability. Their main point is that with symmetry of applicability and symmetry of semantics, both physics and mathematics reasoning is exact and does not permit counter examples.

In context of the previous discussion, mathematics and physics are not universal truths that exist in Platonic realms. Nor do people learn mathematics from the physical world. Rather, both mathematics and physics are selected by sentient beings if they satisfy certain symmetry requirements. Only those statements that satisfy certain symmetry requirements are deemed mathematical statements. Similarly, only those statements that satisfy certain symmetry requirements are deemed physical laws. It is for these reasons that both mathematics and physics have an objective, timeless feel to them. They are chosen that way.

If one accepts these conceptions of physics and mathematics, then it seems one has a “solution” to the applicability problem. The reason that mathematics is applicable in physics is that both the structures of mathematics and the laws of physics are defined the same way. There are complex relationships between domains of discourses for mathematical statements and domains of applicability for physical laws. The physical laws and their concomitant mathematics statements are defined only if they satisfy related symmetries. This solution answers the question of why physics is mathematical, as part of Wigner’s problem.

e. Anthropocentric Solutions

Mark Steiner in his influential book, The Applicability of Mathematics as a Philosophical Problem, (Steiner 1998) presents a version of rational theism as a “solution” to the applicability problem. According to Steiner, humans have a central place in the universe, and the universe is not indifferent to human goals. In other words, the universe is created for humans and people live in a user-friendly universe. Since God has created this universe for humanity, it follows that using human-made mathematical concepts leads to understanding, prediction, and new discoveries.

Steiner describes the early years of quantum mechanics as a showcase for his reasoning in favor of the special place of humans in the world. According to Steiner, by the early 20th century, physicists already knew that they cannot deduce laws of atomic physics from the old classical laws. Nor could the atomic phenomena be directly observed. Moreover, difficulties that accompanied experiments of any sort at the atomic level, turned physics in the early 20th century into a state of despair with a prevalent view that “[a]tomic physics seemed reduced to blind guessing with an uncertain future” (Steiner 1998, p.48). Under these circumstances, physicists had to come up with a strategy to guess the laws, as it was the only option available, Steiner claims. However, since there could be infinitely many possible guesses (thus the probability of finding the right one was close to zero), they needed to adopt a strategy for guessing. This strategy, Steiner claims, was based on mathematical analogies. The use of mathematics in discovering the laws, in Steiner’s view, is a sufficient reason to reject naturalism and accept anthropocentrism.

5. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Arezoo Islami
Email: arezooi@sfsu.edu
San Francisco State University
U. S. A.

and

Noson S. Yanofsky
Email: Noson@sci.brooklyn.cuny.edu
City University of New York
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy