Andrew Baxter (1686/7–1750)
Andrew Baxter was a Scottish philosopher of the early Enlightenment and an important defender of Samuel Clarke’s intellectual legacy in eighteenth-century Britain. In his An Enquiry into the Nature of the Human Soul (1733), Baxter developed a comprehensive metaphysics according to which matter is essentially passive, all physical motion depends on immediate divine agency, and the human soul is immaterial. The Enquiry correspondingly offers sustained and incisive critiques of materialist, skeptical, and idealist positions prominent in his time.
Baxter was an influential participant in several major philosophical debates of the early Scottish Enlightenment. He contested Colin Maclaurin’s interpretation of Newtonian physics, especially over whether gravity should be understood as an immediate exercise of divine power or as part of a causal order that depends on God only ultimately. He provided the first extended philosophical critique of Berkeley’s immaterialism in English, helping to shape the later standard portrayal of Berkeley as a skeptic-turned-idealist verging on solipsism. Reacting to Peter Browne’s account of animal minds, he argued that, just as human beings, animals possess immaterial and naturally immortal souls but left open the question of whether they are also destined for an eternal afterlife. He also engaged directly with William Dudgeon’s determinism, moral intellectualism, and philosophical optimism; furthermore, he defended libertarian free will, the genuine wickedness of some of our choices, and, hence, the reality of moral evil.
Baxter not only defended and developed Clarkean positions but also advanced several original views of his own. He argued that ordinary dreams are produced not by bodily processes or by the dreamer’s own mind but by external immaterial agents—spirits or ghosts. Together with his views on animal minds, this theory forms part of Baxter’s broader attempt to account for forms of mentality beyond ordinary human waking consciousness.
After a brief biography in Section 1, Section 2 outlines Baxter’s basic metaphysical framework, including the passivity of matter, his semi-occasionalist account of causation, and the cosmological argument for the existence of God. Section 3 covers his philosophy of mind: the immateriality and deflationary natural immortality of the soul, his account of animal minds and their immortality, and the principle of mental transparency. Section 4 examines his theory of dreams, covering the elimination of bodily and mental explanations, and his categorical distinction between dreaming and imagination. Section 5 offers his critique of Berkeley’s immaterialism, including his charge of dream skepticism, solipsism, and even atheism. Section 6 presents his moral philosophy in the context of the controversy with Dudgeon. Section 7 briefly assesses his influence and legacy.
Table of Contents
- Life and Works
- Passivity of Matter, Semi-Occasionalism, and God
- Philosophy of Mind
- Dreams
- Critique of Berkeley’s Immaterialism
- Moral Philosophy and the Controversy with Dudgeon
- Influence and Legacy
- References and Further Reading
1. Life and Works
Andrew Baxter was born in Aberdeen in 1686 or 1687, the son of a merchant and Elizabeth Frase. She was well-connected to prominent families in northern Scotland. Andrew was educated at King’s College in Aberdeen, and he spent his working life as a tutor to the sons of the nobility. He married Alice McBane, the daughter of a Berwickshire clergyman in 1724 and had four children. As described by his family and contemporaries, he was not only studious to a fault (often reading through the night), but equally cheerful and modest, albeit severely economical and elegant in manner. Contemporary sources note that he was very popular with younger men. Offers of an appointment in the Church of England to what was essentially a high-ranking clergy position, did not persuade him to take orders and become a clergyman.
Baxter lived from 1741 to 1747 on the Continent. He accompanied Lord Blantyre and Mr. Hay of Drummelzier, two pupils of his, to Utrecht, and he made trips to Flanders, France, and the Holy Roman Empire. An accidental meeting with John Wilkes at Spa in 1745 produced a correspondence and friendship that continued for the rest of Baxter’s life. Baxter died on the 23rd of April1750 at Whittingehame in East Lothian, where he had been living in the household of the Hay family. He was buried in their family vault.
His principal philosophical work, An Enquiry into the Nature of the Human Soul, appeared in October 1733 and was published anonymously. A second edition followed in 1737, and a third in 1745—with neither edition bearing an author’s name—by which time the work had nonetheless attracted significant attention and controversy. The latter edition, though split into two volumes to accommodate its more readable typeface, left the content largely unchanged. An Appendix responding to Colin Maclaurin’s Account of Sir Isaac Newton’s Philosophical Discoveries appeared posthumously in 1750 and was dedicated to John Wilkes. A further posthumous work based on Baxter’s manuscripts, The Evidence of Reason in Proof of the Immortality of the Soul, was published by John Duncan in 1779.
His Reflections on William Dudgeon’s The State of the Moral World Considered appeared in 1732, shortly before the first Enquiry. It was published anonymously, and only a letter discovered in the twenty-first century confirms Baxter’s authorship. He also wrote Matho, sive Cosmotheoria Puerilis (1738), a Latin introduction to Newtonian astronomy prepared for his pupils, which he later translated and vastly expanded into a two-volume English edition. In addition, he composed a dialogue entitled Histor whose principal interlocutor—representing Wilkes—defends Newton and Clarke against Leibniz. However, the publisher Millar declined to print it, reportedly on the basis of three reviewers’ assessments that the topic had lost interest and that the work was rather long-winded. The latter assessment arguably applies to Baxter’s other writings as well—though it clearly did not deter publishers in those cases. As a remark at the end of his essay on dreams suggests, Baxter himself was aware of the limitations of his somewhat repetitive style.
Baxter was well connected within Scottish intellectual life. He corresponded with Henry Home (Lord Kames), one of the leading figures of the Scottish Enlightenment and an early mentor and lifelong friend of David Hume. In addition to Wilkes and others, he was friends with William Warburton, who praised the Enquiry as displaying “admirable metaphysics” greatly superior to Berkeley’s “most miserable of all sophisms” (Notes to Alexander Pope’s Epilogue to the Satires).
2. Passivity of Matter, Semi-Occasionalism, and God
Baxter’s metaphysics is grounded in the legacy of Samuel Clarke and a Clarkean interpretation of Newtonian natural philosophy. The central aim of the Enquiry is to defend the claim that matter is essentially passive and incapable of genuine causal activity, and to infer from this that motion and change in the physical world require continuous and immediate immaterial agency. Since, as is shown below, Baxter does not treat all kinds of causation in the same way, his position can be described as a form of semi-occasionalism.
a. The Passivity of Matter
Baxter’s argument for the passivity of matter turns on the notion of vis inertiae (the force of inertia). The essential features of matter—solidity and extension—ground its disposition to resist change and remain in its present state unless acted upon by an external cause. This inertia, he insists, is an essentially passive power, wholly incompatible with genuine activity, such as self-motion. In this respect, Baxter departs from more cautious Newtonians such as Maclaurin, who took Newton’s empirical method to limit metaphysical conclusions. Baxter, by contrast, treats Newton’s account of inertia, and its characterization as passive, as licensing a demonstrative argument about the nature of matter and causation: so long as matter is matter—characterized by nothing but inertial properties—it cannot possess genuine causal power.
Clarke similarly describes matter as possessing only a negative power of remaining at rest or continuing in motion, and Baxter adopts and extends this line of reasoning arguably drawing on a broader Newtonian tradition that also includes Richard Bentley’s Boyle Lectures. In particular, Baxter extends his argument for the passivity of matter to the ether, rejecting contemporary attempts to explain gravity by means of an ethereal medium. While such theories were intended to avoid action at a distance by supplying a contact-based mechanism, Baxter argues that they merely relocate the difficulty. Even if action at a distance is unintelligible, as he concedes, it does not follow that an ethereal medium must be posited. This is not only because there is no positive evidence for such a medium but, more importantly, because if the ether is itself material, it must possess the same essential properties as all matter, including inertia and resistance. It therefore inherits the very problem of passivity it was introduced to solve. The true source of motion must instead be immaterial. Baxter’s conclusion is that “gravity is not the action of matter upon matter, but the virtue and power of an immaterial cause, or being, constantly impressed upon it” (Enquiry I.34). Indeed, all physical motion, and perhaps even matter itself, depends at every moment on the continued activity of God.
The natural question is whether the inertial properties of matter really require God to intervene in every instance of physical interaction. Baxter’s answer is yes. Unlike thinkers such as Locke, who allow that God initiates motion while passive powers inherent in matter explain subsequent physical interactions, Baxter maintains that the conception of matter as a “powerless, dead substance” excludes it from any genuine causal role, even as a secondary cause (Enquiry I.80). This is also where he parts company with Maclaurin. For Maclaurin, the laws of motion describe the regular operation of the natural world, itself created by and ultimately dependent upon God, but one in which physical interactions nonetheless have a genuine explanatory role. For Baxter, by contrast, the Newtonian laws of motion describe only the regular manner in which divine causation is continually and immediately exercised upon passive matter. His argument rests on his general causal principle—that a cause must possess the power required to produce its effect—applied to the specific case of the transfer of motion. Although inert matter can resist or rebound motion, a body, being wholly passive, has no active power by which motion, construed as a new state in another body, could be produced, and therefore cannot itself explain its transfer.
The problem is not merely that matter lacks activity, but that it lacks the resources to explain the production and transfer of motion at all. Baxter reinforces this point by appealing to the absence of any knowledge in material objects of how to bring about their effects. This is broadly Clarkean in spirit since Clarke likewise restricts genuine causation to free and intelligent agents. However, as will be shown below, this line of argument sits uneasily with Baxter’s attempt to preserve finite immaterial agency. In any event, Baxter rejects both the attribution of inherent activity to matter and the view that the mechanical interaction of passive, inertial bodies, even if initially set in motion by God, can explain natural phenomena. In place of body–body causation, he argues that all bodily change must ultimately be traced to immaterial agency and, above all, to God.
b. Semi-Occasionalism and the Cosmological Argument
While Baxter aligns with traditional occasionalists like Malebranche in denying genuine causal efficacy to material substances, his overall position is better described as a form of semi-occasionalism. For body–body interaction, Baxter is a strict occasionalist: bodies have no active powers, and all physical motions depend entirely on divine operation. This line of reasoning naturally seems also to preclude the possibility of body–mind causation. As will be shown, this is complicated by his critique of Berkeley’s immaterialism, insofar as he requires material objects to be the causes of our sensory ideas. Most likely, however, he means them to be merely occasional causes for God to act immediately on our minds in perception—a move that, of course, leaves unanswered Berkeley’s pre-emptive objection that such a view makes God dependent on matter in much the same way that a musician depends on a written score.
But causal power is not eliminated from the created world altogether. Human and animal souls retain a capacity for causal contribution in the world, and Baxter’s account of dreaming extends the scope of agents to other finite spirits who are capable of producing bodily effects in us. In the case of ordinary, voluntary actions, he believes that the soul initiates spontaneous motion (say lifting one’s arm) through volition. Baxter holds that the soul acts directly on a subtle part of the brain, while the remaining bodily processes involved in executing an act depend on divine agency. As mentioned above, this is not completely compatible with his critique of material causation. Though a person is aware that he wills to move his arm and the resulting movement, he is not aware of how this volition produces the prerequisite changes directly in the brain, any more than he is aware of the processes of animal spirits through the bodily chain. By contrast, the external spirits posited in his theory of dreams are sometimes credited with the knowledge required to affect our brains and, through them, our minds. The tension is mitigated, if not fully resolved, by interpreting the case as one of concurrentism in which God’s cooperation supplies knowledge of the bodily processes involved in a person’s volitional actions while a person remains fully responsible for the volitional decision itself.
Mind–mind interaction or mental operations—such as producing new combinations of ideas or directing our attention to certain ideas in our minds—appear, for Baxter, to presuppose a straightforward form of agent causation in which the soul acts in full awareness of its own acts and independently of divine concurrence (apart, of course, from God’s role in sustaining both the soul and its bodily correlate in existence). Taken together, these commitments yield a tripartite conception of causation: strict occasionalism for body-body (and body-mind) interaction; a sort of concurrentism for mind-body action, with the soul as primary initiator and God as co-operator; and direct agent causation for purely mental activity. This is not a fully systematic or, perhaps, consistent position, but reflects Baxter’s attempt to combine a strict denial of material causation with a robust account of finite immaterial agency.
The most important theological implication of this semi-occasionalist metaphysics is the cosmological argument it supports. Starting from the essential passivity of matter, Baxter argues that motion cannot originate within the material world and must be attributed to an immaterial mover. While Clarke develops this into a modal argument for a necessary being inferred from the contingent existence of things, Baxter’s emphasis is closer to a first-mover argument. But, unlike Locke and other traditional first-mover theorists, Baxter’s God is not merely a temporal initiator of motion from outside the universe, he is the constantly operative primary cause of all physical change. Not only every change or annihilation in bodies, but even their inertial tendency to preserve their states, depends on divine “continued creation” in every single moment (Enquiry I.227). Baxter’s point, as explained in the final section of the Enquiry, is not merely that matter depends on God for its motion, but that it cannot be co-eternal with God as an “eternal effect” of an eternal cause. Moreover, in the same section, he develops a fuller modal argument from matter’s contingency. Matter’s quantity, location, configuration, and state of motion are all capable of being otherwise, whereas the manner of a self-existent being’s existence must be necessary and immutable.
This theological dimension connects directly to Baxter’s critique of both materialists like Hobbes and immaterialists like Berkeley. For Baxter, the materialist either denies God outright or reduces divine agency to an idle wheel in nature; or, at the extreme, commits what Baxter calls Spinoza’s “absurd assertion” of making God and the material world the same thing, “confounding the most opposite natures in the universe” (Enquiry I.80). Baxter also dedicates the final section of his work to refuting the eternity of matter—an aim closely aligned with the anti-materialist agenda of his predecessors, such as Clarke and Cudworth. More interestingly, Baxter also argues that if there is no material world whose existence and continuous motion require explanation, we lose the primary premise for inferring God as its cause. Therefore, both materialists, who assert the self-sufficiency of matter, and idealists, who deny the existence of matter altogether, equally undermine the basis of natural theology. In Baxter’s view, both positions ultimately contribute to atheism.
3. Philosophy of Mind
Baxter’s philosophy of mind can be organized around three interconnected commitments: a rejection of materialist accounts of mind, including the thinking-matter hypothesis; an account of the soul’s immortality; and a principle of mental transparency that both clarifies the nature of consciousness and underpins his theory of dreaming. On these grounds, he is committed to the immateriality of both animal and human souls.
a. The Causal Axiom, and the Immateriality and Immortality of the Soul
The argument for the immateriality of the soul rests on what Baxter regards as a foundational causal principle: “it is impossible the effect should be perfecter than its cause, either in kind, or in degree” (Enquiry I.358). If an effect possessed a perfection not contained in its cause, that perfection would be uncaused—“effected and not effected”—which is a contradiction. More generally, a cause must contain, at least to the same degree, the perfection or property it produces. Baxter argues that denying this principle would allow effects to arise without adequate causes, making anything capable of arising from anything and thereby undermining all rational explanation. Ultimately, such a denial would also undermine our belief in the eternal Reason or Mind in which all truth is grounded, amounting to nothing less than “downright Atheism” (Enquiry I.359–61). This causal axiom—accepted by many of his predecessors, including Cudworth and Clarke—functions as Baxter’s master argumentative principle, deployed throughout his discussions of matter, mind, dreams, animal souls, and the existence of God.
Applied to the case of mind, the causal axiom is meant to rule out both reductive mechanical accounts of cognition—associated by Baxter with ancient atomists such as Lucretius and with Hobbes—and the Lockean hypothesis of thinking matter, according to which God might superadd cognitive states to suitably organized bodies. The thinking-matter hypothesis would require higher perfections—including spontaneity, sensation, and thought—to arise from “the mere addition, or junction, of things dead and inert” (Enquiry I.236). In Baxter’s view, deriving active and perceptive properties from what is wholly passive and unthinking violates the causal axiom, showing that the notion of thinking matter is ultimately incoherent. A similar difficulty arises, indeed a fortiori, for reductive materialists who identify mental states with passive, insentient, and unthinking mechanical processes such as motion.
Alongside this argument is a reductionist mereological commitment, familiar from Clarke’s controversy with Collins, which Baxter treats as an obvious corollary of the causal axiom: no genuinely new perfection can arise from the mere aggregation of parts that do not already possess it in some degree. Therefore, even a composite material system such as the brain cannot give rise to thought if its constituent parts, each brain cell, are wholly non-thinking on their own. Like Clarke, Baxter complements this anti-emergentism with an appeal to the simplicity of consciousness. Since thought and sensation are unified and indivisible, they cannot be properties of a composite substance. The problem is not only that each part of a thinking piece of matter would have to think, however dimly, if the whole were genuinely to think. Rather, even granting this impossible scenario, a collection of little subjects of thought would still fail to explain the full unity and indivisibility of consciousness. Sensation and thought must therefore belong to a simple, immaterial subject, distinct from a composite material object.
Accordingly, Baxter maintains that both sensation—which we share with animals—and specifically human forms of reflective thought are grounded in immaterial substances possessing the requisite powers essentially and indivisibly. While the foregoing arguments apply equally to sensation and thought, Baxter also advances a consideration specific to thought; namely that genuine thought requires spontaneous activity, in particular the ability to direct one’s conscious attention toward one object rather than another. As the argument goes, however, such an uncompelled activity is incompatible with the essential passivity and determinism of material processes.
In the traditional framework, natural immortality is taken to follow from the simplicity of the immaterial soul. A spiritual being, which is without physical parts, cannot be dissolved by any created cause (either by itself or something else), and so, by its own nature, persists immortally without requiring any special divine intervention to sustain it. Baxter at times appears to endorse this view, arguing that the human soul, being simple, is “indissoluble in its nature” and thus can only be destroyed by God and not by any finite power. be destroyed by any finite power, but only by God (Enquiry I.239). On closer inspection, however, he significantly revises the import of this claim and develops a distinctive reinterpretation of it.
For Baxter, the continued existence of any created being—whether material or immaterial—depends entirely on the sustaining activity of God. No being has any intrinsic tendency to persist since each moment of its existence is independent of the previous one and requires a renewed act of divine will (Enquiry I.225–27). The “tendency to persevere in being and existence,” he writes, “hath no other cause but the will of God.” On this view, natural immortality is no longer a distinctive feature of simple, immaterial substances, nor does it follow from their intrinsic nature alone. Rather, “there’s no being but what is naturally immortal,” in the sense that all created beings persist only so long as God preserves them and they cease to exist only when he no longer re-creates them (Enquiry I.243, note h).
Crucially, as he points out, simplicity protects only against the dissolution of a whole into its parts, not against annihilation. As Baxter observes, it is no harder for divine omnipotence to annihilate a simple substance than for finite causes to dissolve a composite one. The role of the simplicity of souls in Baxter’s argument is, as has been shown, primarily to rule out materialist accounts of thought and to ground the unity of consciousness, not to establish a robust doctrine of the soul’s persistence. The latter depends entirely on the divine will. This reconceptualization deflates the traditional notion of natural immortality, severing its connection with simplicity and immateriality. In this respect, Baxter departs from Clarke, who treats natural immortality as both a distinctive and an intrinsic feature of immaterial substances.
b. Animal Souls: Natural and Actual Immortality
Interestingly, most arguments Baxter deploys for human cognition, such as the mereological argument or the lack of explanatory power argument, apply to animal sensation with equal force. No property—including sensation and spontaneous motion—can be produced by or emerge from the mere aggregation of passive, inert parts. Just like human beings, animals, whether elephants or fleas, exhibit internal complexity and spontaneous behavior that require immaterial principles as their cause. Their size is irrelevant: “God doth not disdain to manifest the wonders of his knowledge and power in the narrow bounds of these insect-bodies, nay, to actuate their surprising mechanism continually” (Enquiry I.245, note h). The same causal axiom that establishes the immateriality of all human minds thus establishes the immateriality of animal minds as well.
Indeed, as he argues inversely, proving animal immateriality a fortiori establishes human immateriality since the same causal argument applies uniformly to all sensitive creatures—and perhaps even more clearly to the higher human capacities. Concerning animal cognition, Baxter’s point of departure is a dilemma articulated by Locke in the Second Reply to Stillingfleet: if animals are sentient, then either God has superadded cognitive capacities to their bodies— lending credence to the thinking-matter hypothesis— or they possess immaterial, and therefore naturally immortal, souls, with all the theological difficulties this implies. Baxter resolves the dilemma not by denying animal immateriality but, as has been shown, by challenging the assumption that their natural immortality is theologically troubling and, as will be shown later, by arguing that it may or may not entail an actual afterlife for animals. Allowing animal souls to be immaterial and naturally immortal is therefore, in his view, the only consistent option for those who wish to defend human immateriality and immortality while also rejecting the thinking-matter hypothesis.
In accepting animal immateriality, Baxter explicitly challenges Peter Browne’s opposing account, according to which animal sensation can be explained as a sort of instinct that requires no immaterial soul but arises out of material processes. Baxter explains their disagreement on three methodological assumptions. First, theological modesty: we cannot reject animal immateriality merely because we do not know how God disposes of animal souls at death, any more than we can reject the intricate design of animal bodies because we cannot comprehend the divine craftsmanship behind it. Second, an anti-prejudice principle: one should never reject a well-reasoned conclusion merely because it is strange or unwelcome for whatever other reason. Third, parity of reasoning: as has been shown, the very arguments that establish human immateriality— the passivity of matter, the causal axiom and so on—work equally well for animal immateriality; consistency requires applying, or not applying, them in both cases uniformly.
Baxter’s positive position on animal souls can, again, be stated in three propositions. Animals have immaterial souls—a view that already sets him apart from most of his contemporaries. Animal souls are, moreover, naturally immortal in the deflationary sense established before—they cannot be dissolved or annihilated by any finite cause and persist so long as God chooses to preserve them. Whether animal souls are actually immortal, in the sense of surviving into an eternal afterlife, depends entirely on divine decision—decisions that might be incomprehensible to us—and cannot be settled by arguments from their immateriality or natural immortality alone.
On the third—and most controversial—proposition, Baxter is conspicuously non-committal. The argument for human actual immortality rests on the rational nature of human souls and the moral perfections of God. No comparable rationally perspicuous necessity applies to animals since they lack the rationality, reflective self-consciousness, and moral agency that would make, even to our limited comprehension, eternal afterlife appropriate to divine justice (Enquiry I.352–54). Baxter appears to lean toward the view that animal souls are annihilated by God at or shortly after bodily death. But, like Clarke in his correspondence with Collins, he consistently refuses to foreclose an animal afterlife, noting that a conclusion in its favor would “do no harm to philosophy” (Enquiry I.245, note h), and acknowledging that “some great philosopher should arise who could shew that the souls of brutes are preserved after death, for some wise purpose of the great Author of Nature” (Enquiry I.212–13).
Baxter also inverts Browne’s objection that animal immortality would entail an absurd proliferation of soul-types and eternal experiences. Drawing on the traditional idea of scala naturae (or great chain of being), he argues that the gradation of immaterial beings, with their possible varieties of post-mortem states, manifests divine wisdom and just enhances the richness and beauty of creation. He follows Thomas Burnet in this insight, and he even quotes Burnet without philosophical objection to the suggestion that “if [animals] are capable of any reward, God may have provided proper recompences for them, according to their several natures and capacities” (Demonstration of True Religion [1726], Vol. I, p. 95).
Thus, Baxter’s account of animals helps normalize talk of animal souls and even animal afterlife within an allegedly orthodox theological framework, defending the consistency of human immateriality and immortality. Baxter can thus be seen as anticipating a trajectory that includes Joseph Butler’s Analogy of Religion (1736), John Hildrop’s Free Thoughts upon the Brute-Creation (1742), and Richard Dean’s Essay on the Future Life of Brutes (1768)—authors who engaged with ever-greater confidence with animal souls and the prospect of an afterlife.
Arguably, Baxter’s insistence on the normative (primarily aesthetic) significance of animal souls even influenced the early pioneers of animal ethics, such as Humphry Primatt (Dissertation on the Duty of Mercy, 1776.) Animals are “a part of [God’s] creation and immediate care” (Enquiry II.179, note l), and their instinct is “nothing but the immediate direction and guidance of the Divine Wisdom, to supply the power of reason, which these creatures want” (Enquiry I.209). Of course, attributing to animals immaterial souls, with an important place in God’s creation, also suggests (though Baxter never makes this connection himself) that the destruction of an animal body is ethically as well as metaphysically more significant than Browne’s account would allow, since it involves destroying the bodily conditions necessary for the present activity of an immaterial, divinely created soul. Moreover, unlike the likes of Browne, for whom animal instinct is a disposition built into natural bodily organization, Baxter ties it directly to God’s continuous and providential causal activity and direct supervision or care.
c. Mental Transparency and Infallibility of Self-consciousness
Running through Baxter’s philosophy of mind is a firm commitment to the transparency of the human mind: the mind is aware of all its own contents. It cannot have an idea without being conscious of having it. As he puts it “to be not conscious of its own consciousness, is an undeniable contradiction” (Enquiry II.31, note p). For Baxter, all mental contents, including all mental activity, consist in mental volition, and volition is itself a form of consciousness: one cannot act mentally without being aware of what one wants, and that one wants that. Baxter takes this principle to be broadly shared by Descartes, Locke, and Berkeley, and he uses it as a key premise in his theory of dreaming.
As helpfully observed in recent scholarship, Baxter’s phenomenology, and hence the scope of his transparency principle, allows a distinction between what we might call “sense of agency”—the awareness of oneself as the author and producer of one’s mental acts—and the bare “sense of ownership” over one’s experiential contents or ideas. Accordingly, if we supposed that our own minds produced our dreams, we would be ascribing to the dreamer a sense of ownership without a sense of agency. For Baxter, however, this is not a genuine possibility but rather a modus tollens against the mental origin theory of dreams. The absence of a sense of agency is not a limitation to self-knowledge or the scope of mental transparency, but a correct report that the dreamer does not act in producing the dream-world at all: those acts, as the next section shows, belong entirely to the external spirits acting on the brain.
A related principle concerns the infallibility of consciousness about itself. Whatever is presented in one’s consciousness of one’s own mind regarding any of its particular contents or acts must be the case; to question the infallible authority of self-consciousness would undermine all inference to other minds and the external world, casting doubt on whether the passive phenomenology of our perceptions actually establishes the existence of causes external to our minds. Even more radically, Baxter maintains that the cogito itself presupposes this principle. As he argues, without this principle, it could even be that “for while I fancy I think, it may be some other thing that thinks, while I am not so much as existing” (Enquiry II.54). It is the infallible authority of self-consciousness that guarantees that thoughts occurring to us are in fact ours. If our self-directed awareness could be mistaken, the occurrence of thought would not establish that the thought belongs to the apparent subject, for the thinking might be real while the supposed thinker is not. If this is the right reading of his argument, Baxter goes beyond the familiar skeptical challenges of Gassendi or Foucher, who questioned whether the cogito establishes that the thinking thing is an immaterial substance; the more radical worry Baxter raises is whether the thinking is the subject’s own at all. Alongside the mental transparency thesis, the authority of self-consciousness is therefore the most fundamental epistemic foundation, without which we cannot even know that we exist. Any theory that requires the mind to act without being conscious of doing so, or that presupposes that the mind is mistaken about its own contents or beliefs concerning its own states, is a slippery slope towards solipsism, or what Baxter calls “Egomism”—the view that we have no grounds for asserting the existence of anything beyond our own minds—if not towards ontological nihilism, leaving us without any justification even for our belief in the substantial existence of our own minds.
For disembodied human souls in the afterlife, Baxter argues that this mental transparency is supplemented by the always-thinking thesis: in addition to being infallibly aware of all our mental acts and contents, the soul “not only acts and perceives sometimes, but it always acts and perceives in that state” (Enquiry I.261). For embodied souls, the picture is less clear. In dreamless sleep, for instance, Baxter allows that the soul may be temporarily imperceptive, a concession he makes “to avoid unnecessary debates” between the Lockean and Cartesian positions on whether the mind is passive and unconscious in dreamless sleep, or whether we merely fail to remember its conscious activity afterwards. While we cannot have mental states without being simultaneously aware of them, we may be imperceptive and subsequently forget perceptual states that were once conscious. This epistemological limitation is due to our embodiment: while the body cannot produce change in the soul’s simple, uncompounded nature, nor does it have any power to bring about change in general, its passive nature is such that it can, and occasionally does, restrict the mind’s access to the information provided by the sensory organs and retained in the brain.
4. Dreams
Baxter’s most original philosophical contribution—and one that has attracted as much ridicule as serious attention—is his theory of dreaming, set out in the Essay on the Phaenomenon of Dreaming, which occupies section six of the Enquiry. The theory rests on an unwavering commitment to the transparency of the mind and the infallible authority of self-consciousness, as well as the lack of adequate powers in matter.
a. The Essay on Dreams
The Essay on Dreams is described by Baxter as serving a pre-emptive function within the larger argument of the Enquiry. If bodies are essentially passive and incapable of genuine causal activity, as he argues at length in the first sections of the work, then a natural objection arises: does dreaming not show that bodily mechanisms can produce mental states without immaterial agency? The Essay aims to block this objection by showing that dreaming cannot be explained by bodily mechanisms. Yet t he goes much further by also denying that the dreamer’s own mind could be responsible for dreaming, and, in particular, by developing his own positive theory of the causal origin of dreaming, attributing it to external immaterial agents.
Dreams, Baxter emphasizes, are real phenomena. Like optical illusions, they are positive effects of underlying causes and “as real as the representations of our waking perceptions” (Enquiry II.9); hence, they call for causal explanation. The phenomenological feature Baxter emphasizes most is the passivity of dream experience. This passivity has two aspects: not merely the absence of a feeling of producing one’s experiences— what might be called non-voluntariness, or the mere lack of the sense of agency mentioned above)— but also a positive experience of content being imposed on or against one’s will: dream representations are “involuntarily intruded” upon the soul (Enquiry II.13), and the dreamer is “just as passive in receiving these impressions” as in waking perception (Enquiry II.13–14).
While emphasizing the passivity of dreaming, Baxter draws a careful distinction that is easy to miss. Within the dream, the dreamer is also active: she forms genuine volitions, responds to apparent others, and experiences herself as an agent among agents. As he puts it, there is “the same difference and distinction of consciousness, betwixt what the soul itself doth, and what the persons in the vision seem to do” as in waking life (Enquiry II.35, note p). The dreamer is thus passive with respect to the dream-world presented to her, but active in responding to it. This distinction between the active dreaming subject and the passively received dream-world identifies the target of his dream theory more precisely. The spiritual origin is meant to explain not the acts in dreams that the dreamer appears to perform herself, but the emergence of the dream-world she inhabits and passively experiences.
The alternative explanations Baxter considers are three: dreams are caused by (i) the dreamer’s body, (ii) the dreamer’s own mind, or (iii) chance (he also dismisses the hypothesis that the external spirit is God). Of the alternatives, he rules out chance the quickest on the mere ground that “chance” is just a word for unknown causes. To treat it as an efficient cause, and hence a potential explanation of phenomena like dreams, would allow “any thing to do any thing” (Enquiry II.25, 56). Underlying this rejection is Baxter’s broader demand that real effects have adequate causes, in keeping with the general causal intelligibility of the created world. The bodily and mental origin hypotheses receive much more extended treatment.
b. The Elimination Argument
The bodily origin hypothesis is eliminated by the causal axiom: bodies are not only passive and inert, but the perfections they possess cannot produce effects — such as the structured, intelligent, and often wildly creative content of dreams — that exceed their own. Baxter thinks that the brain is a necessary condition for dreaming, serving as the medium through which the impressions are conveyed to the soul and providing the raw materials from earlier experiences, but it cannot be the efficient cause of dream content. The bodily state of sleep merely provides the occasion for external agents to act in the same way that bodily processes serve as occasions for divine action in Baxter’s broader semi-occasionalism.
More specifically, Baxter argues that bodily mechanisms cannot account for two characteristic features of dream content: its signs of intelligence and spontaneity (language use, rational response, apparent agency of dream figures, and the internal order of dream events), and its extraordinary irregularity, craziness and creativity. Indeed, he thinks its creativeness already shows it cannot come from either a bodily or a merely human source. In particular, if bodily mechanisms produced dreams, “the impressions would be determined, and invariable, without life and diversity; just the opposites of what they are” (Enquiry II.26). The wildness, extravagance, and unpredictability of dreams exclude a mechanical, deterministic explanation just as much as the conspicuously rational features and purposeful behavior of dream figures defy a blind, unintelligent cause.
The mental origin hypothesis is eliminated by a combination of the transparency principle and phenomenological observations. Given the infallibility of self-consciousness, the aforementioned phenomenological passivity entails that the dreamer’s own mind is not producing the dream content. Baxter supports this conclusion with several converging arguments. First, if the mind were producing its own dreams, it would have to be doing so unconsciously, which contradicts the mental transparency principle. Second, the mind cannot be both the agent and the patient of the same act: it would have to consist of “two distinct Beings, each ignorant of the other’s consciousness and designs; and the whole compounded soul be diverted with the contrivance on the one hand, and yet terrified with the execution of it on the other” (Enquiry II.16). Splitting the mind up so radically clearly violates the essential simplicity of consciousness. Third, the danger in a dream “appears real” , and this reality-experience would be impossible if we were simultaneously its author (Enquiry II.14). If we were deceiving ourselves, the deception and frightening aspect would simply not work.
On this basis, Baxter concludes that external immaterial spirits — finite, ghost-like agents — are the only possible explanation of dreaming. He, nonetheless, acknowledges the counterintuitive character of this conclusion but insists that fear of implications should not prevent following a sound argument wherever it leads. The spiritual origin is, in fact, presented not merely as the only coherent explanation but as one that elegantly accounts for all types of dreaming. Ordinary and extraordinary or prophetic dreams (widely attributed to God or other external spirits) differ only in their relation to subsequent events—whether what appeared in the vision comes to pass or not—not in their intrinsic features; a unified causal explanation of both is therefore to be preferred.
The spirits responsible for our ordinary dreams are finite, imperfect agents—which explains the mixed character of dream experience, its combination of rational and irrational elements—but possess the knowledge of how to affect the brain and, through it, the soul, a knowledge the soul itself lacks when acting on its own body through volition. While obviously capable of producing our dreams, external spiritual agents such as angels and God are excluded as their causes on the grounds that dreams, especially nightmares, are often chaotic, distressing, and morally problematic, and hence incompatible with their fundamentally benevolent and wise nature (this argument is arguably not entirely convincing, given Baxter’s willingness elsewhere to acknowledge that God may have reasons for his actions that remain hidden from us). Other human minds, in turn, would lack both the motivation and the ability to affect us directly. Baxter is careful to note that the spirits’ power over us is not unlimited: God constrains their activity, ensuring that waking experience retains its coherence. As Baxter puts it, “Surely it is because there is a God of truths who sets boundaries to the power of these Beings, that we are not deluded into the extremest Scepticism by them; that our waking senses are not so bewildered with inconsistencies of facts and persons, as to confound human reason” (Enquiry II.215–16). This divine constraint explains why the spiritual origin of dreams does not lead to a more radical skepticism about waking life. Although the spirits are real, their activity is limited to our dreaming lives and held in check during waking by a benevolent God who is not a deceiver, and hence would not allow for such a full-scale deception by ghosts.
c. Dreaming and Imagination
The categorical distinction Andrew Baxter draws between dreaming and imagination represents a significant refinement over the coarser-grained psychology of his predecessors. Hobbes, Locke, and Berkeley largely followed a tradition that placed both sleeping and waking fancy under a single faculty of imagination. For Baxter, they are entirely different. Dream scenes are involuntarily forced upon the soul. They are caused by external, immaterial spirits acting directly upon physical brain traces while our waking senses are shut. By contrast, imagination is an active, voluntary exercise of the mind. The soul actively couples ideas together and is fully conscious of its own workmanship. As Baxter writes “that [the soul] should couple together ideas by this active power, without being conscious of its own workmanship, is as little to be conceived” (Enquiry II.34, note p). We know when we are imagining because it is an act we perform. By contrast, we only recognize that we were dreaming retrospectively through weird, mismatched signs, and only because we can know we are awake when we are.
Moreover, Baxter points out that overlooking this fundamental distinction creates a major problem for both Locke and Berkeley who, inheriting the Hobbesian view, lump dreaming and imagination together as mental acts and ideas produced by our own minds. Insofar as dreams present themselves as entirely passive experiences, classifying them as self-generated mental activities akin to imagination violates both mental transparency and the infallibility of self-consciousness. Berkeley in particular is caught between two bad options. Either dreams are unconsciously produced by the mind, which violates these mental principles, or God produces them, in which case they would be ‘real’ as ideas of perception. Even more devastatingly for his common-sense aspirations, if the mind can unconsciously trick itself in sleep, Berkeley loses his core rule of felt passivity for distinguishing reality from illusion or dream. This gives another spin to Baxter’s charge that Berkeley’s philosophy collapses reality into a dream (for this standard critique, see below).
There is another distinction between imagination and dreaming based on how the soul links to matter. Imagination is the perception of a picture impressed on the brain. This “shews not only that the soul is immaterial, but that it is united to a material sensory, where the picture is impressed” (Enquiry II.305). In this respect, imagination is the faculty that connects the soul to matter, proving humans have a dual ontological status. While dreaming similarly involves both the mind and the body, the mechanism is different. During dreams, external spirits bypass normal sensory channels to act directly upon those physical brain traces, forcing content onto the soul.
Through this elaborate discussion of dreams, Baxter is not merely attacking his contemporaries or explaining the causal origin of dreaming. He is at the same time offering a positive, and rather distinctive, theory of dreams that assigns dreaming considerable philosophical significance. Thinkers such as Locke largely dismissed the wildness of dreams as mere “craziness” and “frivolous” mind-wandering, or the by-product of bodily indisposition. Baxter strongly objects to this dismissal. He argues instead that dreaming has a positive epistemic value, perhaps even exceeding that of ordinary waking thought. While the body remains necessary for dreaming, the sleeping body does not simply inhibit mental activity. Rather, it allows the dreaming mind to function without being constantly engaged—indeed, bombarded—by external sensory impressions.
Baxter not only points out that the creativity of dreams often surpasses that of waking artists, he also draws attention to what might be called their “unfounded familiarity”: the phenomenon common in dreams whereby new things, strangers, or surprising situations appear familiar to us, and we effortlessly navigate them as though we had encountered them before. Such phenomena show, for Baxter, that dreaming is far more than the decayed residue of waking perceptions or a symptom of bodily disorder. Instead, dreams reveal the hidden powers of the soul, offering a temporary glimpse of the higher and more direct mode of cognition that the soul will enjoy once entirely freed from the body in the afterlife.
5. Critique of Berkeley’s Immaterialism
Baxter’s examination of Berkeley’s Principles of Human Knowledge (1710), “Dean Berkeley’s Scheme against the Existence of Matter and a Material World Examined, and Shewn Inconclusive,” constitutes the first extended philosophical critique of Berkeley’s immaterialism in English. Berkeley, on Baxter’s reading, is not the sophisticated anti-skeptic he presents himself as but a Pyrrhonist in disguise whose principles lead consistently to atheism and solipsism.
a. Theological Motivation, Demonstration, and Perception
In his attack on Berkeley, one of Baxter’s primary motivations is theological. His cosmological argument for God’s existence, as has been shown , proceeds from the passivity of matter to the necessity of an immaterial first and continuous mover. Berkeley’s denial of matter removes the very premise on which this argument depends. The design argument equally loses its basis if there is no material world to exhibit extraordinary features, such as a wonderful design.
Moreover, the same inference from unperceived causes of our ideas to their non-existence—a sort of argument from ignorance Baxter attributes to Berkeley in his rejection of matter—if applied consistently, also threatens other minds as well as God himself: “God, not being perceived, either is not; or is but a very perception in the mind of man: Absit blasphemia! [Away with this blasphemy!]” (Enquiry II.270). A further theological danger follows from Berkeley’s attempt to account for our ideas exclusively by God’s direct causal activity, as opposed to the material world or other minds serving at least as an occasional cause for them. But if God directly excites the ideas in us that lead us to believe in material things or other minds while only our ideas do in fact exist, then, as Baxter argues, God is systematically deceiving us. Making God a deceiver is not purely a metaphysical worry for him, familiar from Descartes’s First Meditation, , but also imputes to God responsibility for our sins. When we think we are being tempted by another person to commit an immoral act, “God immediately tempts us” (Enquiry II.313).
Baxter also raises methodological worries concerning the nature of proof we should be after when it comes to the existence of matter. For Baxter, necessary truths only concern essences that can be demonstrated a priori, while existential claims are contingent, supported by empirical evidence or inference. In Baxter’s eyes, therefore, Berkeley’s demand for a “downright demonstration” of the non-existence of matter—or his claim to have demonstrated its impossibility—rests on a category mistake, applying the standard appropriate to necessary truths to a contingent existential question. Affirming the existence of matter involves no contradiction between its essential properties, and the compatibility of extension and solidity in a substance is a conceptual claim that remains true whether any material object actually exists or not. For Baxter, the appropriate evidence for existential claims is empirical which can never reach the absolute certainty of necessary truths. In fact, like Locke and many others, Baxter believes that “the knowledge of the existence of external material objects, by sense, is certain knowledge, and the evidence as great as the reasonable soul can desire” (Enquiry II.317).
Anticipating what is perhaps the most widespread criticism of Berkeley, Baxter argues that the central argument in Principles §4 begs the question. Berkeley moves from the premises that we perceive sensible objects and that we perceive only our own ideas to the conclusion that sensible objects are nothing but our ideas. As Baxter notes, this transition “takes for granted that we perceive nothing but our own sensations,” labelling it “sleight-of-hand reasoning” (Enquiry II.287–88). By assuming this identity, Berkeley simultaneously presupposes a Lockean representative theory of perception and conflates the objects of perception with the sensations themselves, whereas for the Lockean indirect realist objects of perception can exist apart from our ideas. For Baxter, one can reflect upon a sensation as a mental object without implying that the sensation is identical to the external entity causing it, thereby preserving the vital distinction between the act of perception and the independent object.
A related argument concerns the divisibility of ideas. If Berkeley’s thesis holds—that for unthinking, sensible things, their esse is percipi—then, as Baxter believes, ideas cannot account for our experience of extended, divisible objects. Because Baxter takes ideas to be inherently indivisible, they lack the structural capacity to contain parts. Yet, our everyday perception clearly reveals to us physical parts as well as spatial extension. Since our perceptions, as ideas, are indivisible while the objects they represent are not, Baxter concludes we must be perceiving a material world beyond the contents of our own minds: “if our ideas have no parts, and yet if we perceive parts, it is plain we perceive something more than our own perceptions” (Enquiry II.337). This argument, of course, opens a can of worms concerning Baxter’s own underdeveloped account of representation.
b. Self-Defeating Dream Skepticism
As one of his earliest and most important objections, Baxter also argues that Berkeleyan idealism ultimately rests on a form of dream-based skepticism that is self-defeating. One problem Baxter raises concerns the source of dream content. As has been shown , he believes that the content of dreams depends on prior waking experience of external objects. Baxter’s own external spirits, for instance, can only produce in dreamers images drawn from their waking encounters with the material world—even if they can, and do, recombine and embellish these memories in ways that far exceed the bounds of ordinary imagination. But, on all accounts, he believes that dreams presuppose the previous perception of reality. The global dream skeptic who uses dreaming to undermine our knowledge of the external world, therefore, relies on a phenomenon whose content is itself constituted by the very knowledge she claims is unavailable.
A slightly stronger variant of this argument goes as follows: dreaming denotes a species of illusion—the experience of mind-dependent content as if it were mind-independent reality—and illusion is a correlative concept that presupposes a contrast class. One possesses, and hence can deploy, the concept of dreaming only if one also possesses a workable concept of its opposite: waking reality or veridical experience. If all is a dream “the very distinction between dreaming and not dreaming is taken quite away” (Enquiry II.236, note a). In other words, on Baxter’s reading, an idealism construed as the claim that all reality is dream-like is internally inconsistent. Taken by themselves, however, these points seem to beg the question against Berkeley. Berkeley does not require the perceptual source of dreaming (or imagination) to be a mind-independent reality, but merely a form of reality sufficiently distinguished from dreaming. Moreover, he does not define waking reality in terms of mind-independence but rather in terms of the distinctive features of ideas of sense, such as their vividness, orderliness, and origin in the divine will.
Baxter’s objection becomes more interesting when understood as involving a second step. The concept of mind-independent reality—which, on Baxter’s reading, not only gives ‘dreaming’ its contrastive meaning but is required for Berkeley to argue against it—must derive whatever content it has from actual or possible experience. If it lacks such experiential grounding, then the idealist denial of mind-independent reality becomes empty or meaningless, since one no longer possesses a determinate concept of what is being denied. If, on the other hand, the concept does have content, that content must ultimately come from some actual or possible experience of a mind-independent reality. Yet this would presuppose precisely the kind of reality that Berkeley seeks to deny. This dilemma is especially pressing for Berkeley because of his concept empiricism. Following Locke, Berkeley seems committed to the view that ideas, and therefore the content of our concepts, come from experience. He therefore seems to have no way of giving content to the concept of mind-independent reality, since such a reality cannot be experienced under idealism.
A Berkeleyan might respond by arguing that even if our concepts come from experience, experiencing P may be enough to give us the concepts of both P and not-P through negation, without requiring any direct experience of not-P. Moreover, Berkeley’s doctrine of notions, introduced to explain our knowledge of minds and relations in contrast to our sensory ideas, provides another way of forming concepts that does not depend on prior sensory experience. Part of Baxter’s concern may also come from reading Berkeley as trying to show not merely that matter does not exist, but that it is logically impossible because its concept, under any description, contains a contradiction. If that were Berkeley’s position, the concept of mind-independent reality would be not only something that we cannot directly experience it would be conceptually incoherent and therefore impossible to genuinely conceive . On Baxter’s account, this would also make it impossible for Berkeley to deny mind-independent reality coherently.
This argument targets global skepticism, the claim that all experience might be dream-like and lack a mind-independent object. Even if Berkeley’s idealism avoids the self-defeating objection to global dream skepticism, Baxter’s concerns can be reformulated at the level of local dream skepticism. Perhaps not all experience is dream-like, but any particular experience could be—and this possibility can itself motivate idealist conclusions. Indeed, one way of insulating oneself from local dream skepticism is to deny that perception ever places us in contact with mind-independent objects. If all ideas are ontologically alike, and none corresponds to an external material object, then the distinction between dreaming and waking can no longer threaten our knowledge of reality in the traditional way. This is especially interesting because Baxter not only attributes the subjective indistinguishability of dreaming and waking to Berkeley— not without evidence, though this remains controversial in Berkeley’s case— but also appears to accept it himself. As his discussion of spiritually produced nightmares shows, from the dreamer’s perspective such experiences are indistinguishable from waking reality.
Nonetheless, even this weaker skeptical claim is undermined by Baxter’s appeal to an epistemic asymmetry which he appears to share with Hobbes and arguably with Descartes and Berkeley himself: I cannot know that I am dreaming while I am dreaming, but I can know that I am awake when I am awake. Recognizing a dream as a dream is necessarily retrospective since it requires connecting the dream to a chain of waking memories from outside that state. The same point, though, works in the opposite direction as well. While I am fully awake and able to make those retrospective connections successfully, I am warranted in believing not only that the earlier state was a dream, but also that my present state is not. A radical skeptical response is to suggest that one might merely dream that one is validating such waking-memory connections; but that move simply seems to reinstate the stronger form of global skepticism already criticized as self-defeating or meaningless.
c. The Egomism Charge
There is also a pragmatic inconsistency that Baxter presses against Berkeley. While he does not fully appreciate the extent to which Berkeley can reconstruct ordinary physical objects in terms of ideas, while still preserving as much conceptual space for other minds, including God and finite spirits, as any dualist, Baxter argues that Berkeley’s practice contradicts his theory: writing books, citing evidence, and attempting to persuade readers all presuppose entities whose existence the Principles allegedly undermines. Baxter writes that “His whole enterprise proceeds upon the supposition of the reality of what he is going to confute” (Enquiry II.250). This performative contradiction is, Baxter argues, characteristic of skeptical systems generally: “the design frustrates itself” (Enquiry II.236, note a). We have already seen the theological danger Baxter finds in Berkeley’s idealism, but Baxter sometimes seems to acknowledge that God is still safer in Berkeley’s system than other finite minds.
As it is already clear from this charge, Baxter’s critique of Berkeley also presses the problem of other minds. Perhaps the most historically consequential argument is the charge that Berkeley’s principles lead to what Baxter, borrowing from the Chevalier Andrew Michael Ramsay, calls “Egomism”—what would now be called solipsism. Ramsay had coined the term in his Discourse upon the Theology and Mythology of the Ancients (1727, Vol. II, p. 90), applying it initially (and rather puzzlingly) to certain Spinozists he described as having “fallen into a senseless sort of Scepticism, called Egomism, where every one fancies himself to be the only Being that exists.” Baxter redirects the term against idealism as it is more familiar to us.
The argument runs as follows. Berkeley’s ground for denying matter is that we perceive only sensible qualities—ideas in our minds—and not the supposed material substances underlying them. But activity and perceptivity, the only properties by which we infer the existence of spiritual substances, are likewise not directly perceived but inferred. If the argument is good in one case, it is equally good in the other: “if it demonstrate matter out of existence, it equally demonstrates all substance out of existence, save the mind thus percipient, without excepting the Deity himself” (Enquiry II.258–59). Were Berkeley’s case against matter sound, it would exclude other minds as well.
Baxter deploys the concept of Egomism in a second context as well. In the Essay on Dreams, he argues that any theory which allows the soul to produce what it consciously experiences as the product of another agent undermines self-consciousness as the foundation of all inference to other minds: “this assertion, that the soul itself may produce what it thinks another Agent produces in sleep, destroys the evidence of self-consciousness, which is the surest and most intuitive foundation of all our knowledge” (Enquiry II.53). Baxter’s concern is not merely that we may fail to notice some of our mental activity but, as has been shown , self-consciousness is both transparent and infallible. If the soul can produce ideas while consciously experiencing them as the effects of another agent, then self-consciousness ceases to be a reliable guide to our minds. As a consequence, the very same phenomenology by which we ordinarily distinguish our own mental activity from that of external agents could no longer provide secure grounds for inferring the existence of other minds. This second route to Egomism is thus not specifically tied to idealist or representationalist presuppositions but threatens any theory that allows the mind to act without awareness of its own activity, or to mistake its own activity for that of another agent. Still, it has particular force against Berkeley since, on Baxter’s view, idealism rests on the same mistake about all our ideas—waking or dreaming.
To briefly evaluate his criticism of Berkeley: Baxter vastly overemphasizes the dream-skeptical elements in Berkeley, fails to grasp the significance of Berkeley’s attack on abstract ideas, and accordingly misconstrues esse is percipi as a demonstrative argument from the fact that we perceive only ideas to the impossibility of matter rather than as a clarification of what it means for sensible objects to exist. He does not pay any attention to Berkeley’s distinction between our knowledge of ideas and our knowledge of spiritual beings, mental operations, and relations between ideas—a distinction that Berkeley would later articulate more explicitly through his doctrine of notions. Baxter does not address the passages in which Berkeley discusses our knowledge of other minds either and generally underestimates the role of God in Berkeley’s account of reality. Nevertheless, his arguments concerning the sensation–object distinction in perception, the problem of distinguishing reality from illusory states, and the specter of solipsism, resurfaced in important subsequent criticisms of Berkeley.
6. Moral Philosophy and the Controversy with Dudgeon
Baxter’s most sustained engagement with moral philosophy is found in his Some Reflections on a late Pamphlet, called The State of the Moral World Considered (1732). Published just before his Enquiry, this work directly attacks William Dudgeon’s The State of the Moral World Considered (also 1732). Dudgeon was a controversial Scottish freethinker—often called a “farmer philosopher”—who combined philosophical optimism and moral intellectualism with a determinist account of human action. For him, wrongdoing is treated as a form of cognitive mistake rather than genuine wickedness of will, and men fall into vice “by mistaking their true Happiness.” Because of this, Dudgeon believes that every new experience of misery or mistake teaches people to pursue happiness more steadily and correctly.
To this optimistic moral intellectualist core, Dudgeon adds a strict psychological determinism. He argues that the mind is unerringly determined at every moment by the “prepollent,” or strongest, motive—the option that seems to carry the most good with it—and cannot do otherwise. On Baxter’s reading, this combination removes human accountability entirely. Sin is reduced to a mere miscalculation rather than an act of malice or vice, rendering punishment both pointless and unjust. Under this view, the world is best described as a “State of Discipline” in which creatures improve through accumulated experience—failing and then realizing the negative consequences of their bad choices—as opposed to a “State of Trial” in which they are held responsible for their decisions. Baxter’s Reflections attacks this position on three interconnected fronts, developing in the process a positive account of free will that in many ways reflects his broader metaphysics.
a. Against Dudgeon’s State of Discipline
Baxter begins by pointing out the empirical falsity of Dudgeon’s “State of Discipline.” If ignorant miscalculation were the sole reason why people commit crimes, and every such experience taught them to better themselves and improve their moral calculations, then no one would ever repeat the same crime. Yet our experience shows the exact opposite. Far from changing their behavior after having once discovered that some actions are harmful, people tend to build stronger, more incorrigible habits through repeated wrongdoing, leaving this world “hardened” in their vices (Reflections, pp. 5–6). Civilized and populous places, where ethics and moral theories are best understood, are no more free of vice than remote and barbarous ones—the complete reverse of what the discipline hypothesis predicts. If experience and knowledge were the true remedies for vice, the most enlightened ages should be the most virtuous. Conspicuously, they are not, Baxter emphasizes.
Baxter also resists the intellectualist reduction of all wrongdoing to a mistaken calculation of self-interest. Instead, he argues that there is a recognizable human capacity for gratuitous malice—in particular, the taking of pleasure in the pain or destruction of others, with no benefit to oneself beyond the satisfaction of a precontracted vicious habit. His examples include Roman emperors like Caligula, who wished for the destruction of armies, famines, and pestilences, and had persons examined under torture during his entertainments (Reflections, p. 9); Nero’s burning of Rome is also mentioned (Reflections, p. 11). Rather than mistaking their genuine interests, these cases reveal what Baxter calls “the genuine Character of a Devil.” Moreover, he argues that the thesis that no action springs from evil intention “pulls up the Roots of Morality, takes away the Distinction betwixt Just and Unjust, Right and Wrong, Good and Evil; and opens a Door to all Violence and endless Confusions” (Reflections, p. 12).
Baxter thus treats the quality of intention as central to the moral assessment of human action. Their disagreement extends into moral psychology as well. While for Dudgeon the will always follows the best apparent good or rational motive, Baxter thinks that the will can and does deform itself, taking a perverse pleasure in what reason condemns. In this respect, Baxter’s position is much closer to Samuel Clarke’s combination of moral rationalism with psychological voluntarism and libertarian freedom—which sharply distinguishes perceiving a moral obligation from conforming the will to it—than to the moral intellectualist tradition Dudgeon follows. Genuine wickedness on Clarke’s picture, and on Baxter’s, is a failure of the will—indeed the abuse of its freedom—rather than of perception: it is knowing what reason requires and refusing to do it.
Finally, Baxter argues that Dudgeon’s scheme is internally inconsistent. Dudgeon claims both that creatures are improvable through discipline and that they do nothing except what they are propelled to do by the strongest motive and what God designed them to do. This means every action proceeds from strict psychological as well as divine causal determinism. But true improvability presupposes genuine freedom of choice and change. A being capable of improvement through learning, heeding warnings, and acting otherwise cannot at the same time be one whose every single thought and action is unerringly fixed by an external or internal motive (Reflections, p. 20). As Baxter argues, unaccountability and improvability proceed from opposite and inconsistent grounds; they cannot both belong to the same being without repugnancy. Baxter also presses the undesirable consequences this view has for human law. A theory that removes moral accountability removes the rational basis for punishment entirely, yet Dudgeon himself does not go so far as to advocate the abolition of human courts (Reflections, pp. 13–15).
b. The Spring of Human Liberty
Baxter develops a positive account of human freedom organized around the claim that thinking is itself an action of the mind. He believes that the soul’s liberty consists in its spontaneous power to shift attention from one idea to another without this transition being fully determined by a prior motive. By this “Liberty of Indifference,” as he calls it, he means more than the mere ability to decide and act freely in morally indifferent or indeterminate cases, that is, when we have “equipollency” or equivalence between motives— cases in which the determinist cannot explain how we ever escape an eternal inertia and decisionlessness. It is rather the metaphysical “Ground and Foundation” of all our intentional actions (Reflections, pp. 26–27, 32). Here he anticipates his broader metaphysics according to which, as has been shown, matter has no genuine causal power while souls are spontaneous agents.
Apart from cases of equipollency or moral indifference, Baxter also attacks determinism by raising an infinite regress problem. Moral determinists like Dudgeon insist that the mind cannot shift its intentional object without being unerringly determined to do so by the preponderant motive. Yet, if this were true, Baxter points out, the act of deliberation itself would require a prior determining motive, which would, in turn, have to be explained by a further one, and so on indefinitely. Not only would a deterministic account of moral motives render deliberation impossible in principle, it would also make the mind’s constant train of thoughts—shifting swiftly from one idea to another—completely unexpected and inexplicable. As any five-year-old asked to focus on a single thought will readily testify, our minds harbor “arbitrary, unconnected, undesigning Actions and Motions in Abundance” (Reflections, p. 31). This example of mind-wandering is first meant to show that moral or rational motives do not always precede our thoughts. Baxter further argues that the mind—particularly in serious adult thought—does have the direct power to arrest or prolong its attention, to “effectuate a great Variety of Intenseness or Remissness of Thought by its proper Effort.” Baxter regards this power as being as immediate and phenomenologically evident as opening one’s eyes, and likewise independent of any prior moral determination (Reflections, pp. 27–29). This liberty in the transition of thought is the first exercise of our freedom, presupposed by all subsequent intentional action, rather than something that must itself be explained by a prior motive.
As seen before, for Baxter moral evil originates in the abuse of this natural liberty. In such cases, the soul exercises its spontaneous power carelessly, cutting short deliberation before it is complete, allowing a habitually ingrained motive to foreclose any genuine weighing of reasons, or failing to attend to considerations that would have determined a better course. Through repeated acts of this kind, vicious habits are formed that progressively narrow the range of the soul’s free choices, leaving the agent increasingly constrained by his own habits (Reflections, pp. 35, 37–39). Although Baxter does not invoke Aristotle, his account similarly treats vicious character as something gradually formed through the repeated misuse of liberty. The vicious person does not merely miscalculate what is truly beneficial to himself t, as Dudgeon’s intellectualist picture implies, but has effectively trained himself to desire the wrong things and is therefore genuinely blameworthy for actions arising from such habituated desires. He also rebuts Dudgeon’s argument that, since God gave us our faculties, we cannot be blamed for following our natural desires and cultivating our own inclinations accordingly. He offers the example of acquiring a taste for “Snuff and Brandy”— an inclination that “cost us so many Qualms before we can acquire,” but which, once acquired unnaturally and, initially at least, despite our God-given faculties, can become like a “second Nature” (Reflections, pp. 41–42). Baxter’s libertarian account of the spring of human liberty thus allows him to maintain two claims that, in his judgment, Dudgeon’s scheme cannot: namely, that genuine wrongdoing and vice exist, and that the agent who commits them is accountable for them.
c. Foreknowledge, Divine Justice, and Immortality
Baxter also rejects the appeal to divine foreknowledge as an argument against moral accountability. If God designed, or at least foreknew, all our actions, the determinist argues, then those actions were fixed before they occurred, leaving no ground for genuine praise or blame. Baxter’s response is that divine foreknowledge should not be conflated with divine causation. While divine prescience tracks the soul’s choices, those choices originate in the soul’s spontaneous power. To treat foreknowledge as the cause of human decisions and actions is not only to confuse the epistemic with the causal order, but, as Baxter worries, also to render God responsible for what is in fact the soul’s own exercise of liberty (Reflections, pp. 43–45).
Baxter also addresses the question of divine retributive justice. He argues that an infinitely rational being must respond to morally evaluable actions and intentions in proportion to their nature and degree. To do otherwise—for instance, by declining to punish an evil action—is, for Baxter, not an exercise of mercy but of mere partiality. Such partiality is incompatible with the divine perfections, amounting to an irrational refusal to uphold the distinction between good and evil that justice and morality require. By denying the reality of genuine wrongdoing and by treating all human actions as expressions of divine design and foreknowledge, Dudgeon’s scheme, Baxter concludes, undermines the rational basis of punishment. In doing so, it degrades our conception of God from a perfectly rational and just being into one who is indifferent to the distinction between virtue and vice (Reflections, pp. 15–16, 50–51). Furthermore, Baxter explicitly rejects Dudgeon’s claim that divine justice is satisfied by mere annihilation. He contends that mere annihilation—what he calls a “negative punishment”—cannot satisfy the demands of divine justice in the case of heinous, large-scale offences such as those committed by Roman tyrants or oppressors; divine perfection instead requires positive post-mortem punishment strictly proportioned to human wrongdoing (Reflections, p. 48).
Baxter sees Dudgeon’s philosophical optimism—the claim that the created world is as good as it could be, indeed that God necessarily created the best of all possible worlds—as the metaphysical counterpart of this theological misunderstanding. If everything that occurs in the created world is already part of the best possible order, the prospect of future rewards and punishments loses much of its rationale. Moreover, the immortality of the soul becomes morally irrelevant. Baxter, by contrast, firmly believes that the soul’s immortality is the foundation of any moral system. “The Immortality of the Soul,” he writes, “is the weightiest Truth within the Compass of human Enquiry, weightier than even that of the Existence of the Deity itself, since if all is extinguished at once, we cannot have extreme much Concern whether there is a God or not” (Reflections, p. 18). The Reflections thus not only anticipates crucial metaphysical issues and commitment of his later Enquiry but also draws our attention to the theological stakes that drive his broader defense of human agency, immaterialism, and, above all, immortality.
7. Influence and Legacy
Baxter’s critique of Berkeley is arguably the most influential legacy of his work. As has been shown in the scholarship, it anticipates the “skeptical” reading of idealism most often associated with David Hume. It also shaped the interpretation of Berkeley adopted by the Aberdeen common-sense school, particularly Thomas Reid and James Beattie, who attacked the Principles along remarkably similar lines. Reid’s characterization of Berkeleian idealism, for instance, as resulting in “a forlorn state of egoism” resonates very closely with Baxter’s assessment of Berkeley’s position (Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man, pp. 147–48). Further illustrating the influence of his critique, many student essays written for John Stevenson’s class at the University of Edinburgh clearly owe much to Baxter’s argument. Scholars have also argued that, in the intellectual context surrounding Hume, the denial of matter came to be associated not only with skepticism but also with atheism—a development attributable in large part to Baxter’s interpretation of Berkeley. From Berkeley’s perspective, this was of course an ironic outcome, but it nonetheless shaped both the reception of his idealism and Hume’s own philosophical agenda. Thus, although Hume makes no explicit reference to Baxter, he may nonetheless have owed him a significant intellectual debt and may even have targeted aspects of his philosophy.
Baxter’s semi-occasionalist metaphysics generated immediate controversy. Colin Maclaurin and Lord Kames objected to aspects of his account of the passivity of matter. Benjamin Franklin was among the more unexpected critics of his doctrine of passive matter and divine causation. John Jackson’s Dissertation on Matter and Spirit (1735), while sympathetic to many of Baxter’s Clarkean commitments, engaged critically with his reasons for rejecting the thinking-matter hypothesis.
Perhaps unsurprisingly, Baxter’s theory of dreams attracted both incredulous criticism and serious interest. Thomas Branch’s Thoughts on Dreaming (1738) was written as a direct philosophical attack on it. Samuel Taylor Coleridge, who regarded Baxter as having “thought more on the subject of Dreams than any other of our Psychologists, Scotch or English,” on the other hand, engaged very positively with his ideas on imagination and dreaming. Baxter’s dream theory was also influential in the emerging medicalization of dreaming which draws on his view that, in dreaming, the dreaming subject and the creator of the dream scenes are like two consciousnesses—indeed, two agents—active within a single mind. His friend and admirer William Warburton attributed the relative neglect of what he called Baxter’s “noble demonstration” in metaphysics and theology partly to the eccentricity of his dream theory.
8. References and Further Reading
a. Primary References
- Baxter, Andrew. 1732. Some Reflections on a Late Pamphlet, Called the State of the Moral World Considered. Edinburgh.
- Baxter, Andrew. 1733. An Enquiry into the Nature of the Human Soul. London. 3rd ed. 1745, 2 vols.
- Baxter, Andrew. 1738. Matho, sive Cosmotheoria Puerilis. London. Expanded English translation by the author published as Matho: or, the Cosmotheoria Puerilis. 2 vols. London, 1740.
- Baxter, Andrew. 1779. The Evidence of Reason in Proof of the Immortality of the Soul. Ed. John Duncan. London.
b. Secondary References
- Ablondi, Fred. 2013. “Newtonian vs. Newtonian: Baxter and Maclaurin on the Inactivity of Matter.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy 11(1): 15–23. https://doi.org/10.3366/jsp.2013.0044
- Discusses Baxter’s dispute with the fellow-Newtonian Maclaurin over inertia and the passivity of matter.
- Ashman, Lewis. 2026. “Two Pious Newtonians on the Concept of Gravity: Why Andrew Baxter and Colin Maclaurin Disagreed about Divine Causation and the Limits of the Mind.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy 24(1): 1–20. https://doi.org/10.3366/jsp.2026.0433
- Examines the Baxter–Maclaurin disagreement over gravity, divine causation, and Newtonian natural philosophy, situating it within contemporary religious debates.
- Bartha, David. 2025a. “Baxter on Dreams and Imagination: More than a Critic of Locke and Berkeley.” Journal of Modern Philosophy 7. https://doi.org/10.25894/jmp.2812
- Discusses Baxter’s distinction between dreaming and imagination, and the challenges it raises to his more famous predecessors.
- Bartha, Dávid. 2025b. “Baxter and the Spiritual Origin of Dreams.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy 23: 95–117. http://doi.org/10.3366/jsp.2025.0414
- Analyses Baxter’s argument for the spiritual origin of dreams.
- Bartha, David. 2026. “Animal Souls and Immortality in the Browne–Baxter Debate.” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie. https://doi.org/10.1515/agph-2026-002
- Examines Browne’s and Baxter’s divergent responses to Locke’s dilemma about animal sentience, centered on Baxter’s distinction between natural and actual immortality.
- Beer, John. 1997. “Coleridge and Andrew Baxter on Dreaming.” Dreaming 7(2): 157–69. https://doi.org/10.1037/h0094471
- Discusses Coleridge’s rather positive engagement with Baxter on dreaming and imagination.
- Bracken, Harry M. 1957. “Andrew Baxter, Critic of Berkeley.” Journal of the History of Ideas 18(2): 183–204.
- Study of Baxter’s critique of Berkeley and its reception.
- Connolly, Patrick J. 2016. “Maclaurin on Occasionalism: A Reply to Ablondi.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy 14(1): 125–135. https://doi.org/10.3366/jsp.2016.011
- Replies to Ablondi (2013) on Maclaurin’s objections to Baxter’s occasionalism.
- Frankel, Melissa. 2026. “Dreams, Scepticism and Idealism.” https://doi.org/10.1111/theo.70105.
- Traces the narrative connecting Cartesian dream skepticism and Berkeleyan idealism back to Andrew Baxter, while presenting Baxter’s critique of Berkeley as a self-defeating appeal to dream skepticism.
- Frankel, Melissa. Forthcoming. “Dreams, Agency, and ‘the Evidence of Self-Consciousness.’”
- Reconstructs Baxter’s arguments concerning dreaming and self-consciousness, and examines the implications of his dream phenomenology for Descartes’s Cogito.
- Menichelli, Caterina. 2010. “Was Berkeley a Spinozist? A Historiographical Answer (1718–1751).” In Religion and Science in the Age of Enlightenment, edited by Silvia Parigi. Dordrecht: Springer.
- Discusses eighteenth-century responses linking Berkeley with Spinozism and skepticism, including Baxter’s.
- Pearce, Kenneth L. 2024. “Early Modern Critiques of Materialism and Atheism: Cudworth, Clarke, and Berkeley.” In The History and Philosophy of Materialism, edited by John Symons and Charles T. Wolfe, 201–213. London: Routledge.
- Helpful to contextualize Baxter’s anti-materialism and anti-atheism within the broader early modern tradition.
- Rome, Sydney C. 1943. “The Scottish Refutation of Berkeley’s Immaterialism.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 3(3): 313–25.
- Early survey of Scottish criticism of Berkeley, discussing Baxter’s influence in this regard.
- Russell, Paul. 1997. “Wishart, Baxter and Hume’s Letter from a Gentleman.” Hume Studies 23(2): 245–76.
- Discusses Baxter in relation to the intellectual context of Hume’s early reception.
- Russell, Paul. 2008. The Riddle of Hume’s Treatise. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Discusses Baxter, occasionalism, and the context of Hume’s Treatise.
- Russell, Paul. 2021. Recasting Hume and Early Modern Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Draws our attention to Baxter’s place in the intellectual context of Hume.
- Sangiacomo, Andrea. 2018. “Samuel Clarke on Agent Causation, Voluntarism, and Occasionalism.” Science in Context 31(4): 421–456. https://doi.org/10.1017/S0269889718000340
- Provides a lucid account of the Clarke’s metaphysics of agent causation and semi-occasionalism, which is very much in the background of Baxter’s own views.
- Sutton, John. 2010. “Carelessness and Inattention: Mind-wandering and the Physiology of Fantasy from Locke to Hume.” In The Body as Object and Instrument of Knowledge, edited by Charles T. Wolfe and Ofer Gal. Dordrecht: Springer.
- Discusses eighteenth-century theories of fantasy and mind-wandering, including Baxter.
- Uzgalis, William, ed. 2011. The Correspondence of Samuel Clarke and Anthony Collins, 1706–1707. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Modern edition of a key source for the Clarke–Collins controversy, which provides a very important background text for Baxter’s thought.
- Wolf, L. 2022. “Was Clarke a Voluntarist?” Journal of Modern Philosophy 4(1): 6.
- Helpful background material, discussing Clarke’s alleged theological voluntarism.
- Yenter, Timothy. 2023. “The Metaphysical Implications of Newtonianism.” In Scottish Philosophy in the Eighteenth Century, Volume II: Method, Metaphysics, Mind, Language, edited by Aaron Garrett and James A. Harris, 108–43. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Contrasts Baxter’s bold metaphysical style with Maclaurin’s greater caution.
- Yolton, John W. 1984. Thinking Matter: Materialism in Eighteenth-Century Britain. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- Study of eighteenth-century debates about thinking matter, discussing Baxter’s views on the passivity of matter.
Author Information
David Bartha
Email: david.bartha@unimi.it
University of Milan
Italy