Copyediting Guidelines

Each new IEP article will be copyedited by a copy editor. However, it is not the responsibility of a copy editor to turn a poorly written article into a well written article, but only to ensure clarity, revise obvious errors and enforce the Encyclopedia’s style guidelines. Be a minimalist by correcting only errors and obscurities but not the author’s style of presentation of a point.

Regarding style, you might follow the recommendations of the Chicago Manual of Style, with some exceptions that are listed below. Do not be intimidated by this long list because most everything in the list is just common sense. Also, if you are already familiar with copyediting using another style manual, it is acceptable to follow your familiar guidelines. Clarity and consistency of style is more important than a particular style.

New Submissions
Existing Articles
Depth or Extent of Copyediting
Avoid Awkward Phrases
Style Preferences
Last Step: Checkoff List

1. New Submissions

Here is an overview of the copyediting process from the volunteer’s viewpoint. The General Editor (probably Brad Dowden) will send you an original article that has been approved by the professional referees. Normally this will be a Microsoft Word file. Your goal is to produce a copyedited version which you will send back to the General Editor with changes, but normally with no defense given of the changes.

When you are ready to begin copyediting, open your article in Microsoft Word and click on Review | Track Changes | All Markup. Turn off right justification. Then revise (that is, mark up) the document to improve it. Do not need to defend your changes with comments using the Insert | Comment feature of Word; just make the changes. But feel free to make a comment if you’d like some feedback on specific points.

When you are done copyediting, save a marked-up copy of the file under a new name in case you make an error in the next step. Do one last review of your changes by choosing Review | Tracking | Final | No Markup (without accepting the changes) so you can see for yourself how the article will look if all your changes were to be accepted. That last step often helps to reveal new imperfections that you will need to fix. Do not accept your own changes else they will be made but the evidence that they were made will be deleted. Now look at the article and see if there are new errors in red that should be made.

After your marked-up article is received by the General Editor, it will then be read and approved, perhaps with a revision or two, and sent on to a formatter to produce a formatted version that is temporarily posted within the Encyclopedia. The General Editor will acknowledge receipt of your work, but if you do not get an acknowledgement within a week, send a query.

You will receive another notification when the article is posted. This notification will normally be a cc of an email sent to the area editor indicating that he or she can pass along the good news to the author. that the article is posted.

Your identity is never revealed to the author.

When you are available to copyedit another article, let the General Editor know.

2. Existing Articles

For articles that already have been published, but for some reason were not properly copyedited, the General Editor will advise you on the proper procedure for copyediting. Normally this involves using an HTML editor rather than a word processor.

3. Depth or Extent of Copyediting

Unfortunately, academic referees normally confine their remarks to accuracy of the author’s claims and not to grammar, clarity or elegance, so you are our line of defense on those issues.

When you do notice grammar errors and semantic errors, go ahead and make fix them on your new copy of the article.

Here is one example. The author writes:

Certainty is the key criterion here, as for al-Ghazalī there can be no room for doubt in a genuine item of knowledge (for an in depth analysis of al-Ghazālī’s conception of absolute certainty see Hadisi 2022).

The sentence above about Hadisi has some errors. You might rewrite it as:

Certainty is the key criterion here. As for al-Ghazālī, there can be no room for doubt in a genuine item of knowledge. (For an in-depth analysis of al-Ghazālī’s conception of absolute certainty, see (Hadisi 2022).)

About nine changes were made. Changes should be made on your own new copy of the article. Do not bother to add any side comments describing and defending what you did. If you missed some of them, do no worry because they are very minor errors, and the average reader will not notice the differences between the original sentence and the improved sentence.

Here is the list of rules that all good copy editors must follow:

1. Be more or less specific.
2. Use not bad grammars.
3. Proofread carefully to see if you any words out.
4. Don’t use no double negatives.
5. Avoid tumbling off the cliff of triteness into the dark abyss of overused metaphors.
6. Take care that your verb and your subject is in agreement.
7. No sentence fragments.
8. Placing a comma between subject and predicate, is not correct.
9. Who needs rhetorical questions?
10. Use the apostrophe in it’s proper place.
11. Avoid colloquial stuff, like totally.
12. Avoid those run-on sentences you know the ones they stop and then start again they must be separated with semicolons.
13. The passive voice should be used infrequently.
14. And don’t start sentences with a conjunction.
15. Excessive use of exclamation points can be disastrous!!!!
16. Exaggeration is a million times worse than understatement.
17. Stamp out and eliminate redundancy because, if you reread your work, you will find on rereading that a great deal of repetition can be avoided by rereading and editing, so reread your work and improve it by editing out the repetition you noticed during the rereading.
18. Tis incumbent upon one to employ the vernacular and eschew archaisms.
19. It’s not O.K. to use ampersands & abbreviations.
20. Parenthetical remarks (however relevant) are usually (but not always) an obstacle for readers (and make it harder on readers even if you’re being careful) who have the task of understanding your work (article, passage, document, and so forth) as they read.

The list is not original with the IEP.

4. Avoid Awkward Phrases

Confusing, ambiguous, and awkward phrases should be rewritten for clarity. If you notice that rewriting is needed but are unsure how to rewrite it yourself, then indicate this issue in a side comment in your Word document.

Example:

Noting these after-affects, one has to wonder how human experience can be anything but an ineffectual, spectatorial undergoing.

The last two words are confusing. They need to be rewritten like this:

…spectator process.

Maybe you also noticed that the term after-affects is misspelled; it should be after-effects. Grammarly.com will catch all this if you choose to use it. Unfortunately, Grammarly also recommends changes that do not need to be changed. It is not as smart as you would wish it to be.

5. Style Preferences

a. Author Guidelines

Become familiar with the author guidelines so that you have a good sense of what we expect from our authors. You are the enforcer of those guidelines. The IEP prefers the Chicago Manual of Style for its documentation style, but if your author has already written it in APA (American Philosophical Association) style or MLA (Modern Language Association) style or some other coherent style, then you can use that style. And if the author has written the article in New Zealand English or some other non-American English, then do not convert it into American English.

b. Opening Summary

All articles must begin with a 200 to 500 word summary. If it is absent, or not within this range, then add a comment. The summary must not be mentioned in the table of contents nor contain its own heading.

It is OK for the summary to be broken into paragraphs.

Quotations used in the summary should not be given detailed citations; just say who said it. In this sense, the IEP is more like other encyclopedias or Scientific American Magazine than like philosophy journal articles. For example, edit as follows:

Some versions of enactivism – such as those put forward by Thompson (2005, 2007, 2011a, 2011b, 2016) and Di Paolo and others (Di Paolo 2005, Di Paolo et al. 2017, 2018) focus on expanding and developing core ideas of original formulation of enactivism advanced by Varela, Thompson and Rosch. Other versions of enactivism, such as sensorimotor knowledge enactivism (O’Regan & Noë, 2001, Myin & O’Regan 2002, Noë 2004, 2009, 2012; Degenaar & O’Regan 2017, Noë 2021) and radical enactivism (Hutto 2005, Menary 2006, Hutto & Myin 2013, 2017, 2021), incorporate other ideas and influences in their articulation of enactivism, sometimes leaving aside and sometimes challenging core assumptions of the original version of enactivism.

The IEP style is to refer to one of its own articles not as an entry but as an article.

If the author uses the future tense to talk about what is coming in later paragraphs, change it to the present tense. For example, the summary should state that section 3 covers Einstein’s position rather than will cover Einstein’s position.

c. Table of Contents

The opening summary must be followed by a table of contents that indicates the section headings and sub-headings of the article. If this is not the case in the article you are copyediting, go ahead and create the table of contents yourself. Follow the author guidelines, and allow no more depth of sub-headings than those shown in the author guidelines.

Make sure the headings in the table of contents match the headings within the article. One of the most common errors made by authors is to begin their article with a table of contents after their opening summary, then to change the heading of some section during composition of the article and then to forget to go back and also revise the table of contents.

The table of contents can either be flat (for example in the IEP article Solipsism and the Problem of Other Minds) or hierarchical (indented), with main sections and then sub-sections within them (for example in Aztec Philosophy). In either case, the table of contents must use the following structure and labeling convention:

1. Heading
	a. Subheading
	b. Subheading
		i. Subsubheading
		ii. Subsubheading
		iii. Subsubheading
	c. Subheading
2. Heading
	a. Subheading
	b. Subheading
3. References and Further Reading

d. Article Title

Capitalize an IEP article title as if the title were the name of a book. Here is a helpful, free program that capitalizes for you: https://www.prospercircle.org/tools/title-capitalization, although sometimes it does make a mistake. The program capitalizes all the important words (adjectives, adverbs, nouns, verbs) but not prepositions (to, below) and articles (a, the) and conjunctions (or, and). Capitalize the first word even if it is a preposition, and capitalize words that immediately follows a hyphen. Italicize appropriately. Here are three examples:

To Him and Then to Her
Space-Time in Kant’s Prolegomena
Non-Locative Theories of Persistence

For articles on an individual philosopher, the article title must contain the philosopher’s first and last name, birth date, and death date. If the philosopher has died, include the death date. If the philosopher is still alive, leave the death date blank. If both the birth date and the death date are guesses, then use two circas as in: Anaxarchus (c.380—c.320 B.C.E.), or use question marks as in: Anaxarchus (380?—320? B.C.E.). Check that an em dash (—), not a hyphen (-), nor an en dash (–) is used between the two dates. Blank spaces around the em dash must be removed. Within the body of the article rather then a title, use a hyphen rather than an em dash, that is, use Anaxarchus (c.380-c.320 B.C.E.).

In both the article title and the body of the article, check that periods are used in B.C.E. and C.E. without blank spaces. C.E. is only allowed if the year’s number is less than 500. Circa, the Latin word for about, must be abbreviated as c. rather than ca. or CA. There should be no blank space between c. and the date in either a title or in the body of the article. For example, in a title say Anaxagoras (c.500—428 B.C.E.) rather than Anaxagoras (c. 500—428 B.C.E.).

The word century should be abbreviated as cn. and not c. and be separated from the date number with a blank space, for example Alexander Polyhistor (1st cn. B.C.E.). Outside of article titles, the full word century is fine to use also.

If a philosopher is known under two names, then insert the second spelling in parentheses as follows: Zhuangzi (Chuang-Tzu, 369—298 B.C.E.). Do not allow Zhuangzi (Chuang-Tzu) 369—298 B.C.E.

e. Headings and Sub-Headings

Make sure section headings and sub-headings in the article match those in the table of contents. Use your own judgment to fix a disagreement.

Capitalize headings and sub-headings as if they are titles of books. See Article Title for more on this. All article titles, headings and sub-headings must be in caps and smalls. Many authors will use full caps; this mistake must be fixed by the copy editor. The phrase “non-religious faith” can occur in the body of the article, but when it occurs in a heading, capitalize the “r.”

f. Author Information

Remove all titles from the author’s name such as Dr. or Professor. Delete the department name and the university’s street address and city. Do not abbreviate country names except for U. S. A. Note the blank spaces within the abbreviation.

For example, change:

Sir Michael Dummett, professor
email: dummett@csus.edu
Dept. of Philosophy
College of Arts & Sciences
Université de Genève
2010 La Mer Avenue
Geneva, Switzerland

to:

Michael Dummett
Email: dummett@csus.edu
University of Geneva
Switzerland

Use the English translation of university names.

g. American vs. British English

The IEP prefers American English, but other dialects such as British, South African, Australian, and Indian are acceptable. Just be consistent throughout the article.

British spelling examples: Aristotelean, favourite, defence, sceptic, behaviour, realisation, travelling.

American spelling examples: Aristotelian, favorite, defense, skeptic, behavior, realization, traveling.

h. References

Citations within the body of the article can use either of these two styles, with or without pages numbers, so long as the author is consistent throughout the article:

…as Alston argued (Alston 2009).

…as Alston argued (2009).

Page numbers are optional.

The last main section of every IEP article (and thus, every table of contents) must be titled “References and Further Reading.” Authors often will use the terms Sources, Bibliography, References, Readings, or Notes, but change these to References and Further Reading. In the section on References and Further Reading, alphabetize all the references by author’s last name. Do not number the list.

The IEP recommends that authors use the MLA style of references and in-line citations; however, the IEP does not enforce this recommendation and allows almost any style that is coherent in the References and Further Reading section.

References and Further Reading sections in IEP articles can have sub-headings such as Original Sources, More Advanced Studies, and so forth.

When there are more than two entries for the same author, repeat the author’s name in subsequent entries. The MLA and many authors use a long dash in place of the author’s name when it occurs a second time; replace all these dashes with the author’s name.

If a citation contains an item with a list of multiple authors, change any occurrence of “&” in the list to “and.”

Do not permit authors to cite a forthcoming article; highlight this with a comment in your Word version of the article, and the General Editor will decide what to do about it.

i. Hyperlinks (Links, Web Address, URLs)

Hyperlinks, links, web addresses, and URLs are the same thing. Hyperlinks to other articles within the Encyclopedia are always encouraged. Some authors are overly eager to include hyperlinks and will ask for a hyperlink for every occurrence of the term, but you must check to see that there is normally only one link per term, usually upon the term’s first occurrence in the body of the article. An exception would be when two links go to the same place but for different reasons, as when a link occurs to explain what the technical word field means, and then later there is a link to the same place to tell the reader that this is where to look for a discussion of the controversy about the relationship between spacetime and its fields,

We have a strict policy about linking to articles outside of the IEP. We use hyperlinks only for stable resources. The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy and a professional society’s collection of Wittgenstein’s original correspondence are two examples of sites with stable URLs, but a link to an article on someone’s personal Webpage would not be stable because it would be too likely to become broken over the next fifty years.

All these unstable URLs must be removed. If you are unsure whether the author used an unstable URL, indicate this issue in a comment in your Word document.

For URLs, do not let authors add a date accessed.

j. Footnotes and Endnotes

Articles must not contain footnotes or endnotes. If you notice that an IEP article contains them, and you haven’t been told explicitly to include them, indicate this issue in a comment in your Word document.

k. Acknowledgments and Thank Yous

The copy editor must remove all the acknowledgments and thank yous. If one is found, include a comment in your Word document so the General Editor can notify the author and the area editor that it was removed.

l. Latin Abbreviations

Replace Latin abbreviations. Here are the replacements:

Exceptions: It is OK to use a priori, ibid., op. cit., vice versa, and vs.

m. Self Reference

Revise these sorts of unnecessary self-referential terms by using the phrasing that follows in brackets:

Consider my opening sentence [Consider the opening sentence}.

This concludes what I take to be the major influences on Mitchell’s thought. [This concludes the major influences on Mitchell’s thought.]

My book about him says… [Jones (2005) says…]

I believe Passmore’s description is right. [Passmore’s description is generally accepted.]

We will show in the next section… [The next section shows…]

n. Pejorative Terms

Do not permit your authors to use pejorative phrases.

Examples: which certain irrational philosophers still believe. the idealist curse.

Personal attacks and snide remarks must be removed.

o. Italics

Use italics or quotation marks for emphasis, never boldface or underlining.

Use italics to name something, unless using quotation marks would be clearer. Here is an example using italics: Philosophers have named them entities, things, and objects. Here is an example where quotation marks are clearer. Replace:

For any sentence S, if S is true, then S.

with

For any sentence S, if “S” is true, then S.

p. Dates

For a date range, such as 62-113 C.E., use an em dash (—) within an article title, but a hyphen within the body of the article and its table of contents.

The IEP is multicultural, so we do not want to place all events on a Christian timeline that uses AD and BC. Therefore, change B.C., BC, and BCE to B.C.E. (which means Before the Common Era). Do not use blank spaces within B.C.E., but do insert a blank space between the year and the B.C.E. Change Pliny (A.D. 62-113) to Pliny (62-113 C.E.). Note: the IEP does not normally use C.E. for any date after 500 C.E.

If you encounter c. or circa in birth/death dates, change these to ca. and use no space between it and the number.

Regarding the word century in birth/death dates, authors may use fourth century, fourth cn, 4^th century, and 4^th cn provided the article’s style is consistent.

Regarding approximate dates, our style is to use either, for example, Ramanuja (ca.1017-ca.1137) or Ramanuja (1017?-1137?). Within article titles the hyphen should be replaced by an em dash.

For disputed dates within a definite range, do not use circa, ca, or question marks, but instead use this style: Ramanuja (1017/21-1137). If only a death date is known, then use Ramanuja (d. 1137) with a blank space after the period.

q. Initials

You can use either J.M.E. McTaggart or J. M. E. McTaggart, but the key is to be consistent throughout the article. If referring to a person by using only their initials, then use no spaces and no periods, as in FDR.

r. Using “Now” and “Recent”

Do not allow these temporal terms: now, currently, at present, recent, recently, presently, a few years ago, now, to date, does not yet exist. For example, if your author writes, “Recently this topic has become attractive to philosophers of mathematics …,” change this to, “In the first two decades of the twenty-first century, this topic became attractive to philosophers of mathematics.” There can be exceptions to this policy, but the point is that the sentence shouldn’t risk changing from true to false if it were being read eighty years after its publication.

Always allow the word now within direct quotations or in passages in which it means as a consequence rather than at present. Here is an example of an acceptable use of now:

This implies that x = 23. Because y = 2, now we know x+y = 25.

s. Quotations

IEP articles use two types of quotation formatting. Indent into a block of text for long ones; use quotation marks within the text for short ones.

Long Quotations: Quotations longer than three lines must be introduced with a colon in the previous text, and formatted as a block of text that is indented. Capitalize the first letter of the quotation even if it is not capitalized in the original source. Longer quotations can use multiple paragraphs. Do not enclose the block itself within quotation marks. If a citation occurs at the end of the quotation, then adopt one and only one of these two styles throughout the article:

(i) place it after the final quotation mark enclosed within parentheses, but do not use a period after it.

(ii) place it before the final quotation mark enclosed within parentheses.

Short Quotations: Quotations of three or fewer lines must be inserted inline. In these cases, the quotations must be enclosed within quotation marks. When using a signal phrase to introduce a quotation, do not add a comma at the end of the signal:

Andrew Mclaughlin suggests “Go there.”

not

Andrew Mclaughlin suggests, “Go there.”

Unlike in journal articles, full citations for quotations are not required in IEP articles. Only the author’s name is required.

For an inline quotation it is better to cite at the end of the sentence, not the end of the quotation. So, say:

When he said “I know that I have hands, but I might be a handless brain in a vat,” the remark appears to be inconsistent (Smith 2022).

and not

When he said “I might be a handless brain in a vat,” (Smith 2022) the remark appears to be inconsistent.

The indention of non-quotations of any length is fine; it is a tool for emphasizing something.

The ending period or other punctuation mark goes after the citation in indented quotations. So, Number 1 is correct; not 2:

1. Popper concludes that, although Marxism had originally been a scientific theory:

It broke the methodological rule that we must accept falsification, and it immunized itself against the most blatant refutations of its predictions. Can it be described as non-science—as a metaphysical dream married to a cruel reality (1974, 985)?

or

2. Popper concludes that, although Marxism had originally been a scientific theory:

It broke the methodological rule that we must accept falsification, and it immunized itself against the most blatant refutations of its predictions. Can it be described as non-science—as a metaphysical dream married to a cruel reality? (1974, 985)

t. Punctuation

i. Quotation Marks

The American style uses double quotation marks. The British style uses single quotation marks. The same goes for scare quotes.

ii. Dashes and Hyphens

Replace a double hyphen (- -) and an en dash (–) with an em dash (—), and remove any blank spaces around them.

iii. Colons and Semicolons

For quotations, place the colon and semicolon outside the quotation:

Correct: Kant wrote, “There is no fact of the matter here”; Kripke disagreed with him.

Incorrect: Kant wrote, “There is no fact of the matter here;” Kripke disagreed with him.

Listed items may be made inline or, instead, indented as new paragraphs. List short items with commas, and list long items with semicolons either inline or indented. Both cases must be introduced with a colon. Here are two examples:

Traditionally the arguments for God’s existence have fallen into several families: arguments, miracles, and prudential justifications.

A person is justified in believing that X does not exist if:

(a) all the available evidence used to support the view that X exists is shown to be inadequate;

(b) X is the sort of entity that, if X exists, then there is a presumption that would be evidence adequate to support the view that X exists;

iv. Contractions

Contractions not within quotations must be unpacked. For example, change don’t to do not.

v. Future Tense

Sentences referring to what is included in the article must use the present tense rather than the future tense.

Correct: Both act and rule utilitarianism are discussed in the next section.

Incorrect: Both act and rule utilitarianism will be discussed in the next section.

vi. Non-English Words

Italicize non-English words.

These movements are designed to channel the flow of qi (energy).

In subsequent uses of the term, drop the associated English meaning.

u. Lists

Authors are allowed to choose their own way of producing lists. They might use numbers, letters, caps or smalls, and not be consistent in which they use. However, do add a left parenthesis if they use only a right one. That is, change:

1)
2)

(1)
(2).

Indent lists a standard tab; don’t make them be flush left unless the items listed are very large, say over thirty lines.

6. Last Step: Checkoff List

Most (but not all) of the recommendations described above have been converted into the following task list.

1. Save changes. Turn on Review | Track Changes | All Markup. Save your work early and often.
2. Opening Summary. Check that the article has an opening summary; that its length is in the range of 200-500 words; and that it is not mentioned in the table of contents. Make a Word comment if there is an error here, or fix things yourself.
3. Table of contents. Ensure that the text in the table of contents matches the corresponding heading text in the body of the article. If there is a mismatch, and it is not obvious how to fix it, then describe the problem in a Word comment.
4. Hyperlinks. Check that all hyperlinks point to the correct location and that the hyperlink is not repeated later in the article.
5. Contractions. Search for and unpack contractions that are not part of an externally sourced quotation. Rather than searching for apostrophes, it is usually easier to perform individual searches for: ‘t, ‘d, ’s, ‘re, ‘ve, ‘ll.
6. Quotation marks. Ensure that the style of quotation marks is consistent throughout the article.
7. Emphasis. Use italics and not quotation marks or boldface for emphasis.
8. Final heading. Ensure that the article ends with a References and Further Reading. It is more important that this section’s style be internally consistent than that it conform to one of the famous styles.
9. Periods. Check for missing periods and double periods at the ends of sentences.
10. Dates. With any date range such as “101 B.C.E.-88 B.C.E”, check that an em dash (—) is used in the article’s title, but a hyphen is used within the body of the article.

Additional grammar guidelines are available at:
www.getitwriteonline.com/.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy