Primary and Secondary Qualities: Wright’s Account

It has long been a philosophical problem to explain the commonly accepted distinction between two kinds of qualities: primary and secondary. While the roots of this debate can be traced back to Plato’s Euthyphro, it was John Locke who, more clearly than others, articulated the distinction and introduced the terms “primary quality” and “secondary quality.” Similar distinctions, under labels such as “primary affections,” “primary attributes,” or “original qualities,” also appear in the writings of earlier thinkers, including Galileo Galilei, Robert Boyle, and René Descartes. This article’s focus is not on the historical development of the distinction, but rather on Crispin Wright’s contemporary and well-known “Judgment-Dependent” account of this distinction, which aims to provide a criterion for determining whether a quality should be regarded as secondary.

Metaphysically, a primary quality is often understood as a quality whose instantiation or existence is constituted, or metaphysically determined, by something independent of human responses formed under certain conditions, such as seeing, smelling, or touching. Typical examples include shape, extension, motion, solidity, and number. These qualities are said to be objective because, for instance, if an object’s surface is square-shaped, it has this shape regardless of whether one perceives it as such. In other words, such qualities are mind-independent. Epistemologically, knowledge that an object’s surface is square-shaped is not infallible precisely because the fact that the object possesses this quality is independent of how one perceives it or what one believes about it. Therefore, even if one’s beliefs about these qualities are formed under optimal conditions, they can still be false.

By contrast, a secondary quality is one whose instantiation or existence depends on how one perceives, judges, or responds to it. Typical examples include color, taste, smell, and sound. Consequently, these qualities are often considered subjective. For example, whether an object is red appears to depend on how it looks or how one sees it under certain conditions. Thus, the quality of being red is said to be mind-dependent. Epistemologically, knowledge that an object is red can be infallible because the object’s having that quality depends on one’s perception: if one’s beliefs about these qualities are formed under optimal conditions, they will be guaranteed to be correct.

Wright’s judgment-dependent account offers a criterion for determining whether a given quality is treatable as secondary or “judgment-dependent,” as Wright prefers to call it. By employing this account, he aims to answer two fundamental questions: one metaphysical and one epistemological. If the account successfully shows that a quality is judgment-dependent, Wright can claim that facts about whether an object has that quality are metaphysically determined by the judgments of a suitable subject. The epistemological question, that is, how the subject knows such facts, is answered by appealing to the subject’s direct knowledge of her own judgments. In what follows, this account is introduced step by step and then applied to several crucial cases.

Preliminaries: Primary and Secondary Qualities
1. Response-Dependence: Concepts, Predicates, and Properties
Wright’s Account: The Case of Color
1. The Chameleon Problem
The Four Conditions
Wright’s Account: The Case of Shape
1. Violation of the Independence Condition: The Stability Problem
2. Violation of the A Priority Condition: The Answerability Problem
A Mix of Subjectivity and Objectivity
Relativism, Objectivity, and Secondary Qualities
Wright’s Account: The Case of Intention
1. Violation of the Substantiality Condition
2. Self-Deception as a Positive Presumption
Wright’s Account: The Case of the Moral
1. Moral Values: Neither Primary nor Secondary
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Further Reading

1. Preliminaries: Primary and Secondary Qualities

This section gives a brief review of the roots of the distinction between primary and secondary qualities. As presented in Plato’s Euthyphro (Cooper, 1997, 1-16), both Socrates and Euthyphro agree on an important fact while disagreeing over a crucial explanatory issue concerning that very fact. They both accept the claim that whatever is loved by the gods is pious, and whatever is pious is loved by the gods.

In other words, they agree that there is a covariance between two facts, presented in this biconditional: the fact that an action is pious co-varies with the fact that it is loved by the gods. Put simply, an action is pious if and only if it is loved by the gods.

Neither Socrates nor Euthyphro questions the existence or validity of this covariance; both agree that the biconditional is true. What they disagree about is how to answer the following questions: Which side of the biconditional has priority? Which fact constitutes the other? Or, as Wright puts it, what is the “order of determination” here (Wright, 1992, 108-109)? The biconditional allows for two possible explanatory directions:

First: Because an action is pious, it is loved by the gods.

Second: Because an action is loved by the gods, it is pious.

Socrates and Euthyphro each endorse a different order of determination. Socrates holds that if an action is pious, it is not because it is loved by the gods; rather, its piousness depends on something else, such as the nature or characteristics of the action itself. Nonetheless, since the gods love pious actions, they love that action too. As previously emphasized, both agree on the truth of the biconditional, but for Socrates, the fact that an action is pious is not constituted by the gods’ responses, judgments, or attitudes. Thus, Socrates treats piousness as a primary quality, constituted independently of the gods’ responses.

Euthyphro, by contrast, believes that the piousness of an action essentially depends on the gods’ loving it. This aligns with the notion of a secondary quality, where the fact of an action having the quality is constituted by the gods’ responses. Euthyphro thus takes piousness to be a secondary quality. Wright refers to this type of disagreement about the order of determination as the “Euthyphro Contrast” (1992, 108, 37). Neither Socrates nor Euthyphro has offered an account of why their respective orders of determination are correct, and the purpose of Wright’s account is to provide such an explanation.

To generalize this contrast, replace “the gods” with a subject, S, “the action” with an object or event, x, “being pious” with an arbitrary quality, F, and the gods’ loving responses with the subject’s “judgment” to arrive at the following formulation of the biconditional:

Basic Equation: (x)(S): x is F ↔ S judges that x is F, under certain conditions.

This equation is what Wright calls the “Basic Equation” (1992, 108). It represents the covariance between the fact that x is F and the fact that S judges that x is F. Different examples can be generated by substituting “F” with various qualities, such as being red, having a square-shaped surface, or being salty. For instance, people often accurately see an object as red if it is red, and if an object is red, it typically looks red to them. This covariance between x’s being red and S’s judging that x is red is a fact that people generally agree on. The challenge lies in explaining this covariance by determining which side of the equation accounts for the other.

Before introducing Wright’s approach to this issue, it will be helpful to clarify some basic but important points that may otherwise cause confusion in the discussion that follows.

a. Response-Dependence: Concepts, Predicates, and Properties

Judgment-dependent accounts (hereafter “J-D accounts”) are a subclass of the more general category of “response-dependent” accounts (hereafter “R-D accounts”). The term “response-dependence” was first coined by Mark Johnston in his influential paper “Dispositional Theories of Value” (1989). Wright takes the relevant responses in these accounts to be certain mental responses, namely, one’s judgments or opinions. This is because, in areas of particular philosophical interest, non-judgmental responses, such as “nausea, amusement, certain forms of aesthetic response, having things look red, or square to one, and so on” (Wright, 1992, 111), are not sufficiently rich to capture the complex interdependence between a quality and the subject’s responses. Addressing the Euthyphronic question (or fixing the order of determination) in these areas of discourse, including intention, meaning, morality, politics, and economics, requires a more fine-grained notion.

“Judgment” often simply means a belief or opinion formed in response to the world. However, Wright adopts a more sophisticated definition: “the response of judgement… [is the response] of endorsing what is affirmed by a tokening of an assertoric sentence of the discourse” (1992, 111). Here, judgments are framed within the philosophy of language. Consider the discourse of color. An assertoric sentence within this discourse might be “That apple is red.” When a speaker makes this assertion, what is affirmed is the content of the sentence, namely, that the apple is red. Thus, to judge that the apple is red is to endorse what the assertoric sentence expresses. Given this, what are these judgments about?

Philosophical discussions reveal a diversity of notions employed in building R-D accounts, most notably properties (or qualities), concepts, and predicates. For instance, John McDowell, one of the first philosophers who employed the notion of secondary qualities to address philosophical problems concerning values, uses the notion of property (more specifically, disposition) and offers a disposition-oriented reading of secondary qualities: “A secondary quality is a property the ascription of which to an object is not adequately understood except as true, if it is true, in virtue of the object’s disposition to present a certain sort of perceptual appearance” (McDowell, 1985, 111-112). Thus, if red is a secondary quality, “that rose is red” is a true ascription of color to the rose if it is disposed to look red to people under optimal conditions.

Johnston, who first formally developed a disposition-based R-D account known as the “response-dispositional” account (1998, 14), shifts his focus from concepts to properties in a notable way. Initially, he was concerned with response-dependent concepts and their connection to the concept of objects having dispositions to appear a certain way to normal observers. In 1989, he defined a response-dependent concept as one interdependent with concepts of subjects’ responses under certain conditions (see Johnston, 1989, 145). By 1992, he introduced the idea of “response-dispositional concepts,” stating that one who claims that the following equation, or biconditional, is a priori knowable to be true is asserting that the concept of red is a response-dispositional (that is, secondary) concept:

The property red = the standardly realized disposition to look red to standard perceivers under standard conditions. (Johnston, 1992, 230)

While Johnston’s emphasis was initially on concepts, he argues that his account could also demonstrate that “redness would also be a genuine property” (1989, 10), partly because the term “red” has a reference. By 1993 and fully by 1998, Johnston’s account had shifted to focus explicitly on “response-dependent properties.” He asserts that a property, being F, is response-dependent if the following biconditional can be made a priori knowable and necessary:

x is F if and only if x is disposed to produce x-directed response R in all actual and possible subjects, S, under conditions C. (1998, 9)

In contrast, Richard Holton argues that “response-dependence is a feature of concepts, not of properties” (Holton, 1991, 4) and later defines response-dependent concepts as “concepts which are connected, in an a priori way, with certain human responses” (1992, 183).

Frank Jackson (1996) offers a definition of redness similar to Johnston’s but with an emphasis on determining the reference of the response-dependent term “red”: “‘red’ denotes the property of an object putatively presented in visual experience when that object looks red” (Jackson, 1996, 200).

Philip Pettit, in his extensive work on the topic, employs all the notions of properties, concepts, and predicates while aiming to remain neutral about the metaphysical status of properties. He states:

The property that we fix upon, the property that provides the referent of our concept of redness, is that property whose instances evoke red sensations in normal observers under normal circumstances. (Pettit, 1991, 609)

For Pettit, the concern of an R-D account is not to determine what this property precisely is: “In maintaining that the concept is response-dependent… all that we may mean is that… the concept hooks on to that property, whichever it is, that evokes red sensations under normal conditions” (1991, 609).

In 2002, Jackson and Pettit jointly sought to build on Johnston’s R-D account, committing to a communitarian R-D view, according to which “an English term ‘T’ will be response-dependent just so far as it is a priori that ‘T’ serves to pick out a property (or whatever) in something if and only if that thing would seem T under certain independent, favourable specifications” (Jackson and Pettit, 2002, 101). This view, while aligning with Johnston’s earlier approach seeing concepts as the main bearer of R-D accounts, allows for the possibility that while a response-dependent term or concept can successfully refer to an objective property, this success in referring, and even the existence of the property, cannot be guaranteed because “observers may not prove to converge on any property of the kind envisaged, under conditions that count independently as favourable” (2002, 102). In this way, their view integrates elements from Johnston, Jackson, and Pettit. Why is there disagreement among philosophers on these notions?

Simon Blackburn clarifies where these disputes arise: “For some of us there is not much of a difference here: I myself see properties as the semantic shadows of predicates, not as self-standing objects of investigation. But others see the matter differently” (Blackburn, 1993, 262). For the philosophers discussed above, significant distinctions between properties, concepts, and predicates affect whether these terms can be used interchangeably in an R-D account. Properties or qualities are features of objects or events in the world, such as an apple’s being red or a table’s having a square-shaped surface. R-D accounts seek to determine whether the fact that an object has a particular property depends on facts about normal observers’ responses. If red objects are thought of as forming a specific set, the R-D account asks whether an object’s membership in that set is determined by one’s responses or independently of them.

Concepts are typically regarded as mental items employed in thought, while predicates are linguistic items or structures that appear in sentences expressing those thoughts. Since concepts have a specific extension, which only specific objects fall under, they can be seen as representing the set of objects that instantiate a property. In this sense, the concept of red and the term “red” can be said to refer to, or represent, the property of being red.

However, two properties may be identical, while the concepts ascribing them are not. Blackburn notes that some philosophers “think of there being a substantive science of identifying the property [j] which is not the same thing as identifying the concept [j]” (1993, 262). The classic example is water and H₂O: having the property of being water is the same as having the property of being H₂O, whether or not a person actually knows this fact. However, having the concept of water is different from having the concept of H₂O; one may possess the former without the latter. This is one reason why Holton argues that response-dependency is a feature of concepts, not properties. What about predicates?

A predicate such as “… is red” or “x is red” is an incomplete linguistic structure that forms a complete sentence when “…” or “x” refers to something, and it forms a true sentence when what “…” or “x” refers to is indeed red. Predicates are thus true of specific objects only, for instance, the set of red objects, and are said to have satisfaction, correctness, or application conditions. The predicate “x is red” is satisfied or correctly applied if and only if the object denoted by “x” has the property of being red. The relationship between properties, concepts, and predicates can be summarized as follows: “a predicate like ‘… is red’… can be used to ascribe the property of redness to things.… At the same time, this predicate ‘… is red’ expresses the concept red” (Wedgwood, 2013, 976). However, a similar issue arises concerning the relationship between predicates and concepts. In the philosophy of language, it is well known that two terms or predicates can refer to the same property while presenting it in different ways: they have the same referent but different Fregean senses, resulting in distinct concepts.

This matter will not be pursued further. The aim of the above discussion has been to clarify some of the significant disputes concerning the boundaries of response-dependency and to highlight the general features of R-D accounts. This article will now introduce Wright’s account by focusing first on two cases: color, as the typical example of a secondary quality, and shape, as the typical example of a primary quality. In each case, Wright discusses the relevant concepts and their extensions, though, as will be seen, he prefers to characterize response-dependence in terms of the distribution of truth-values across a class of judgments within each discourse. After presenting Wright’s J-D account in these two cases, I will explain how this account addresses the more complex case of intention and, finally, the most controversial case in this discussion: moral values.

2. Wright’s Account: The Case of Color

To begin with, consider the basic equation for color concepts, such as the concept of red:

RED: (x)(S): x is red ↔ S judges that x is red, under certain conditions.

The key question is whether it is S’s judgments that determine the extension of the concept of red. Here, the concern is with judgments formed “under certain conditions.” More precisely, S’s best judgments are needed, that is, those formed “under certain optimal conditions” (Wright, 1992, 108, 111). This is necessary in light of the familiar Wittgensteinian remark that not every judgment a subject forms can be trusted or treated as reliable: it is not the case that whatever seems right to the subject is right. If the subject is color-blind, suffers from brain damage affecting vision, observes the object in poor lighting, or is inattentive, then the subject’s judgment about x’s color cannot be trusted. What is needed are the subject’s best judgments about x’s color, and best judgments are those formed under optimal conditions. The first step, therefore, is to specify what these optimal conditions would be.

Some of these conditions have already been mentioned. Importantly, Wright is not after finding ideal conditions – for reasons to come – but rather what are ordinarily regarded as statistically normal conditions for color observation. These conditions have two components: one about the environment and one concerning the subject or observer. On the environmental side, the conditions are like the following: “the surface must be in full view and in good light, relatively stationary, and not too far away” (2001, 192), with lighting conditions typically specified as “those which actually typically obtain out-of-doors and out-of-shadow at noon on a cloudy summer’s day” (2001, 195). These are generally treated as the conditions under which an object’s color can best be observed. On the part of the observer, “the thinker must know which object is in question, must observe it attentively, must be possessed of normal visual equipment and be otherwise cognitively lucid, and must be competent with the concept blue. In addition, the thinker must be free of doubt about the satisfaction of any of these conditions” (2001, 192-193).

It is crucial to note that having the concept of red is part of the optimal conditions. Without the concept, the subject cannot form any judgment about it; one cannot judge about something for which one has no concept or understanding. However, possessing the concept of red does not entail knowing the color of any particular object.

Once these conditions are met, the judgment formed can be taken as the subject’s best and most reliable judgment about the color of the object The next step is to show what role this judgment plays in determining the extension of the concept, that is, in determining x’s color. Before turning to this, it is important to address a key complication with the “basic equation” as formulated above, in which the optimal conditions appear on the right-hand side of the biconditional. For Wright, this formulation introduces a potential problem that must be dealt with first.

a. The Chameleon Problem

Suppose it has been established that color is a secondary quality, and thus the fact that an object is red is constituted by the subject’s best judgment formed under optimal conditions. It is clear that the obtaining of optimal conditions should not change the fact being judged, namely, that the object in question is red. However, consider the following case.

Suppose our subject is ready to judge the color of a chameleon, and the chameleon’s skin is currently red. The fact in question is that the chameleon is red, and the judgment will be “the chameleon is red.” The goal is to examine the explanatory role of S’s judgment in determining the truth of this fact. The basic equation here would be:

CH_RED: The chameleon is red ↔ S judges that it is red, under optimal conditions.

Consider the right-hand side of the above equation. Since it says that S forms their judgment regarding the chameleon’s color under optimal conditions, it can be written in the following conditional form:

Optimal conditions obtain → S judges that the chameleon is red.

Thus, the above basic equation becomes:

CH_RED: The chameleon is red ↔ (Optimal conditions obtain → S judges that the chameleon is red).

Now, suppose the chameleon is in a dark room on a green carpet. To form their best judgment, the subject requires the optimal conditions to obtain, which include the conditions regarding appropriate lighting. Under these lighting conditions, however, the chameleon changes its skin color to green, matching the carpet. The subject’s best judgment, therefore, would not be that the chameleon is red, but that it is green. This would make the right-hand side of the biconditional false, since under optimal conditions S would not judge that the chameleon is red. Does this mean that red is not a secondary quality?

It may seem tempting to resolve the issue by rewriting the equation as:

CH_GREEN: The chameleon is green ↔ (Optimal conditions obtain → S judges that the chameleon is green).

However, this move introduces a deeper problem. How could the subject know that the chameleon is green before the optimal conditions obtain and thus before the subject even forms their best judgment under those conditions? Before the obtaining of the optimal conditions, all that the subject knew was that the chameleon is red. If S knew and could already judge that the chameleon is green prior to the obtaining of optimal conditions, it would imply that the color had been fixed independently of their best judgment, undermining the treatment of color as a secondary quality.

This problem, identified by Johnston (1993, 121) as the problem of “altering,” highlights that the obtaining of optimal conditions may unpredictably alter the facts or truth-conditions of the sentences by which one describes those facts about the colors of objects, and thus directly affect the subject’s judgments. Wright offers a solution to this challenge.

According to Wright, the basic equation should be reformulated as follows:

PE_CH: Optimal conditions obtain → (the chameleon is green ↔ S judges that the chameleon is green).

Here, the condition that optimal conditions obtain is moved to the antecedent of a conditional, with the biconditional placed in the consequent. This means that once optimal conditions obtain, the fact to be examined will be that the chameleon’s skin is green, and the subject will judge it to be so. (Similarly, if the chameleon is red under optimal conditions, the subject will judge it to be red.) Thus, in the case of red, the equation that Wright’s account works with becomes:

PE_RED: (x)(S): Optimal conditions obtain → (x is red ↔ S judges that x is red).

This formulation, which Wright calls a “Provisional Equation” (PE) (1992, 119; 2001, 194), ensures that the obtaining of optimal conditions does not change the fact under scrutiny, while preserving the covariance between judgment and the property in question. The equation is called “provisional” precisely because it is provisioned by, or is conditional on, the obtaining of optimal conditions.

As noted earlier, Wright still needs to demonstrate whether color is indeed a secondary quality, since PEs merely capture the covariance between judgments and colors. This covariance can be explained in two ways:

(1) Euthyphronic (Extension-Determining): Facts about the object’s color and S’s best judgments covary because it is S’s judgments that constitute facts about the color of the object. In this case, judgments are said to play an “extension-determining” role (2001, 192), making the concept of color “judgment-dependent” or secondary: the extension of color concepts is determined by S’s best judgments.

(2) Socratic (Extension-Tracking): Facts about the object’s color and S’s best judgments covary because the subject’s perceptual apparatus is well-suited to accurately capture independently constituted color facts. Here, judgments are said to play an “extension-reflecting” or “extension-tracking” role (2001, 192): they merely detect, track, or reflect the extension of color concepts, making them “judgment-independent” or primary.

Wright must establish which explanation applies to color concepts, such as the concept of red. To address this, he introduces four specific conditions that, if satisfied, would demonstrate that the concept under consideration is indeed judgment-dependent or secondary.

3. The Four Conditions

According to Wright, in order to show that red is a judgment-dependent or secondary concept, the provisional equation for red (PE_RED) must satisfy four specific conditions.

a. The A Priority Condition

This condition requires that the truth of PE_RED be knowable in an a priori way. First of all, if red is a secondary concept, PE_RED is true because S’s best judgments would then determine the facts about objects being red, ensuring that facts about color co-vary with facts about S’s best judgments. This is precisely what PE_RED states: under optimal conditions, x is red if and only if S judges that x is red.

Second, if red is a secondary quality, a subject who possesses the concept of red would know the truth of PE_RED a priori, that is, simply by reflecting on the concept itself, without needing to appeal to empirical experience (see the a priori and a posteriori article). Possessing the concept of red, understood as secondary, is to know that under appropriate conditions, if an object is red, it is judged to be red, and vice versa. If the A Priority Condition were not met, S would require knowledge beyond reflecting on the concept of red to know that PE_RED is true, implying that S’s best judgments could no longer serve as the conceptual ground for truths about color. This would undermine the secondary status of color. Thus, the A Priority Condition is a necessary condition that must be met if red is secondary.

PE_RED meets the A Priority Condition because any normal person possessing the concept of red would already know that under standard conditions, if an object is red, it will appear red, and vice versa. This is simply what is required to have the concept of red conceived as secondary.

Note, however, that while empirical observation is needed to determine whether a particular object is red, such an inevitable appeal to experience does not undermine the a priori knowability of the truth of PE_RED itself, that is, that what it expresses is true.

Nonetheless, meeting this condition alone does not suffice to establish that red is a secondary quality because PE_RED could be a priori knowable even if color is determined independently of (or by something other than) S’s best judgments.

b. The Substantiality Condition

The optimal conditions must be specified in a substantial, non-trivial manner, avoiding “whatever-it-takes” formulations that guarantee the correctness of S’s judgments by fiat (see Wright, 2001, 196). If the optimal conditions were defined as “whatever is necessary for S to form correct judgments about color” or contained conditions such as “… and there is no obstacle whatsoever for S to determine the color of x…,” the truth of PE_RED would be trivial. One would no longer be able to claim that the truth of PE_RED owes specifically and exclusively to the fact that S’s best judgments determine facts about redness, rather than simply to the obtaining of the conditions themself. If the Substantiality Condition is violated, it remains entirely indeterminate whether S’s judgments, if formed under substantially specified optimal conditions, would still determine facts about x’s color.

The optimal conditions Wright specifies, such as S possessing the concept, being attentive, having normal visual equipment, and observing under appropriate lighting, do not guarantee that S will always form correct judgments about color, but they are sufficient to enable only reliable judgments. This shows that the Substantiality Condition is met in the case of red.

Note that this is why Wright relies on statistically normal conditions rather than ideal conditions, which would involve “whatever conditions are conducive to the reliable appraisal of colour” (1992, 113). “Ideal conditions” would collapse into triviality because they are supposed to be the conditions defined in terms of the deliverance of correct appraisals of color.

Yet, satisfying the Substantiality Condition alone does not rule out the possibility that independent facts may still constitutively be involved in determining color, leaving the judgment merely to track these facts.

c. The Independence Condition

The optimal conditions must not presuppose any fact about the color of the object. If red is a secondary quality, facts about an object’s being red should be determined by S’s best judgment, not assumed beforehand. Presupposing any fact about x’s color in the optimal conditions would raise this question: what determined those facts about x’s color before S forming their best judgment about x’s color? Since such facts are fixed before S makes their best judgment, the judgment cannot be said to play an extension-determining role. Consider an example.

Suppose the optimal conditions included a condition like “x’s color remains stable during the observations S makes.” This requirement would presuppose that x has a specific color, F, that remains stable over a period, implying that the fact about x’s color has been determined somehow independently of S’s best judgment. This undermines the judgment-dependent status of color.

Wright’s formulation of optimal conditions avoids such presuppositions. It requires no assumptions about what color x has or about the stability of x’s color. A point is to be noted at this time.

By looking at PE_RED, one can see that the concept of red appears on both sides of the biconditional. Does this violate the Independence Condition? It has been assumed that S possesses the concept of red, which means that S knows this concept has a certain extension, E, which admits only specific objects. However, Wright argues that this does not violate the Independence Condition because his account is non-reductionist. It does not seek to reduce the concept of red to other concepts or facts about redness to any other facts but instead investigates the relation between S’s judgments and the object’s being red. Thus, using the concept within the biconditional does not assume an extension independently determined prior to judgment (see Wright, 1992, 120–121).

It remains to be seen, however, whether meeting these three conditions suffices to show that red is judgment-dependent, or whether a non-judgment-dependent account might also satisfy them.

d. The Extremal Condition

This condition requires that the satisfaction of the above three conditions owes only to the fact that S’s best judgments determine the concept’s extension. There must be no alternative explanation for why the PE in question satisfies these conditions other than the extension-determining role of S’s best judgment. Wright illustrates this condition using an example.

Consider the case of pain. The PE for this case can be written as follows:

PE_PAIN: If S has the concepts requisite in order to entertain the judgment that she is in pain, then S is in pain at t if and only if S judges that she is in pain at t.

Here, while PE_PAIN appears to meet the first three conditions, this is due to the infallibility of first-person judgments about pain, not because the judgments determine the extension of the concept of pain. Pain is the typical example of the mental states of which a person has a unique qualitative experience: when one feels pain, such a feeling is distinct from that of a tickle, an itch, or similar feelings. Moreover, one has direct, non-inferential knowledge of one’s own pains, without needing to form judgments, beliefs, or inferences to know one is in pain. This means that PE_PAIN is a priori knowable to be true for someone who possesses the concept of pain; the optimal conditions were also substantially specified, and no fact about S’s pain was presupposed in them. Thus, in the case of pain, although the provisional equation meets the three conditions, it does not show that the concept of pain is judgment-dependent; rather, the conditions are satisfied because of the infallibility of first-person awareness (see Wright, 1992, 124).

Therefore, one must carefully distinguish between (a) the cases in which the three conditions are satisfied because S’s judgments have determined the extension of the concept, and (b) the cases in which they are satisfied because of our independent infallibility of the extension of the concept, or other factors, in which case our judgments about the concept’s extension at most track or reflect facts about that extension. The notion of judgment-dependence applies only where no alternative explanation exists for why the conditions are met other than the extension-determining role of S’s judgment. The case of color, as indicated, meets this condition as well.

Therefore, since PE_RED satisfies all four conditions, Wright concludes that color can indeed be viewed as a judgment-dependent or secondary concept: S’s judgments about x’s color, formed under optimal conditions, do not merely track facts about x’s being red but determine them.

Before turning to the case of shape, it is worth recalling that Wright often frames these results in terms of the “distribution of truth values” across judgments within a discourse. For, if color is a judgment-dependent concept, then equations like PE_RED “purport to exhibit a way in which truth values in the discourse in question are … bounded by the deliverances of best opinion” (1992, 120; see also 2012, 404). This connects with Wright’s broader Dummettian anti-realist view of truth and the related notion of superassertibility (see Wright, 1992, Chapter 2; 2003, Chapter 1; see especially the related papers collected in Wright, 1993). A detailed exploration of Wright’s anti-realism cannot occur here, but it is important to note that for judgment-dependent concepts like color, the applicability of the truth predicate to assertions involving these concepts (their truth or falsity) depends on human judgments, which serve as the truth-makers for such assertions.

This concludes Wright’s J-D account of color, showing how red can be treated as a secondary, judgment-dependent concept. The next question is whether the same approach can explain why shape is typically considered a primary concept.

4. Wright’s Account: The Case of Shape

Shape concepts are typically viewed as primary concepts, and Wright argues that his account can explain why this is so. Consider Wright’s example (2001, 197): Suppose there is an object in view with a pear-shaped surface. As with color, one must first set out a provisional equation for x being pear-shaped and specify optimal conditions under which S’s judgments about x’s shape would count as their best judgments:

PE_PEAR: (x)(S): Optimal conditions obtain → (x is pear-shaped ↔ S judges that x is pear-shaped).

Before examining whether PE_PEAR meets the four conditions, the relevant optimal conditions must be identified. Some of them would naturally be similar to those for color because shape also involves visual appraisal: the object must be clearly visible, the environment must not be too dark, dusty, and so forth. The subject must also be perceptually normal, attentive to the shape of the object (rather than its color or other properties), and free from cognitive dysfunction or brain damage. Wright summarizes the optimal conditions for shape as follows:

S knows which object x is, and knowingly observes it in plain view from a sufficient variety of positions in normal perceptual conditions, and is fully attentive to these observations, and is perceptually normal and is prey to no other cognitive disfunction, and is free of doubt about the satisfaction of any of these conditions. (1988, 17)

Although the conditions appear innocuous, a deeper problem lurks beneath the surface.

a. Violation of the Independence Condition: The Stability Problem

Consider the following two questions about the specified optimal conditions:

(1) Would a single observation of x suffice for S to make their best judgment about its shape?

It does not seem so. Unlike color, where a single observation under optimal conditions often suffices, shape judgments typically require viewing the object from multiple angles. It is a common experience to see a square-shaped object as appearing rectangular, rhombus-like, or even trapezoidal. Only after viewing the object from multiple perspectives can one reliably conclude that its surface is square rather than another shape. For this reason, Wright adds the requirement that S observes the object “from a sufficient variety of positions.”

This requirement, however, gives rise to an additional worry: if S must make multiple observations to form their best judgment about x’s shape, then “we must ensure that no change in x’s shape takes place through the period of these several observations” (2001, 197). This leads to the second question:

(2) Can this shape stability requirement be safely included within the optimal conditions?

It does not seem so. For S to make multiple observations, x’s shape must remain stable throughout. This would require adding a condition such as: “the shape of the object remains stable during the period of observation.” However, adding this condition presupposes that x has a determinate shape, F, that remains stable during the period of observing the object from different directions; this is to presuppose some facts about x’s shape in the optimal conditions, which are inevitably constituted before and independently of S’s best judgments. Thus, the Independence Condition, which required that optimal conditions not presuppose facts about the target property, is violated. If shape were secondary, facts about x’s shape would be determined by S’s best judgments. Here, by contrast, x’s shape must already be fixed independently of S’s best judgment. Can the stability problem be avoided?

Wright suggests a teamwork strategy: instead of one subject making multiple observations, multiple subjects could simultaneously observe the object from different angles and report their judgments. If most agree that x is square, this could be taken as the best judgment about x’s shape (see 2001, 197). This might resolve the stability issue and thus preserve the Independence Condition.

However, even if the Independence Condition can be met, Wright argues that shape concepts face a deeper problem: the violation of the A Priority Condition.

b. Violation of the A Priority Condition: The Answerability Problem

Wright observes that “[t]he application of shape predicates, even ones as rough and ready as ‘pear-shaped’, is answerable to a variety of considerations besides visual appearance” (2001, 197). In particular, operational definitions for shape are used. For instance, a square is defined as having four equal sides and four right angles. By having such definitions at hand, would it really matter how accurately or otherwise S observes the object under this or that set of optimal condition? Under such definitions, visual appraisal alone appears insufficient or at least subordinate; measurement becomes decisive. As Wright puts it, “operational criteria dominate the visual” (2001, 198). What is needed is simply to measure the sides and angles to approximately determine the shape. Consequently, S’s visual judgments about shape lose their extension-determining role, instead serving to track facts established by measurement.

Of course, there is no surface in the actual world that is perfectly and ideally square-shaped; even if it is assumed that there are such surfaces, humans do not possess the visual apparatus that accurately detects them. Thus, it seems what is needed is only to determine “approximate square.” To see the problem more clearly, consider the PE for “approximately square”:

PE_SQUARE1: (x)(S): Optimal conditions obtain → (S judges that x is approximately square ↔ x is approximately square).

Now, define approximate squareness operationally:

x is approximately square ↔ (if the four sides and angles of x were correctly measured, the sides would be approximately equal, and the angles approximately right).

The right-hand side of PE_SQUARE1, that is, that “x is approximately square,” can be replaced with this operational definition and arrive at PE_SQUARE2:

PE_SQUARE2: (x)(S): Optimal conditions obtain → (S judges that x is approximately square ↔ (if the four sides and angles of x were correctly measured, the sides would be approximately equal, and the angles approximately right)).

If square were a secondary concept, the A Priority Condition would require PE_SQUARE2 to be knowable to be true a priori by anyone competent with the concept, that is, merely by reflecting on the concept of square or approximately square. The problem is that it is not a priori knowable that judgments under optimal conditions align with operational definitions and precise measurements: this is a contingent, empirical fact. It is not the case that anyone possessing the concept of squareness knows a priori that if correct measurement is made, it would reveal the sides and angles of x to be approximately equal and right. As Wright states, this is a “deep fact of experience” (1988, 20) and only a posteriori knowable. The case becomes worse if more complex shapes and geometric figures are considered.

Hence, the A Priority Condition is violated: in the case of shape, one’s best judgments do not determine the extension of shape concepts but instead track or detect independently established facts.

The conclusion is that, even if one manages to address the stability problem and thus the violation of the Independence Condition, the violation of the A Priority Condition remains. In the case of shape, our best visual judgments serve only an extension-tracking role, rather than an extension-determining one. Shape, therefore, can only be viewed in a Socratic manner, as a primary, judgment-independent concept.

A note on the theoretical framework of this discussion is worth considering. It may be tempting to think that ordinary language users actually learn, come to know, and operate with explicit awareness of the biconditionals or PEs like PE_RED or PE_SQUARE. However, as Pettit clarifies, these biconditionals are theoretical constructs developed by philosophers to capture the structure of everyday practices:

The biconditional belongs to us theorists, not to the participants in the relevant practice. We theorists register how the participants fix on the property that they refer to as redness…. Although participants may have no notion of normal conditions in their repertoire… their practice ensures that it is indeed a priori that something is red just in case it is such as to look red in normal conditions. (Pettit, 1991, 601)

Pettit calls this sort of view “ethocentric” because such accounts, including Pettit’s, rely on the habits and correction practices of ordinary language users (see especially Pettit, 1998, 56-57). One learns to use terms like “red” or “square” through ostensive teaching and communal practices, not by grasping theoretical biconditionals or PEs explicitly: such knowledge is of a know-how sort, not propositional knowledge of some definition or of anything like what PEs express. Philosophers abstract these biconditionals from people’s ordinary practices to test whether concepts are response-dependent or response-independent.

Having examined Wright’s account applied to color and shape, this framework can now be applied to other domains, including mental concepts (such as “intention”) and evaluative concepts (such as “moral goodness”). Before doing so, it will be useful to summarize some of the broader implications of Wright’s discussion for understanding objectivity and subjectivity in the treatment of primary and secondary qualities.

5. A Mix of Subjectivity and Objectivity

A central issue in the discussion of primary and secondary qualities concerns the degree of objectivity and subjectivity that philosophers attribute to them. These notions typically hinge on the notion of dependence on human responses, including perceptions, dispositions, judgments, beliefs, observations, and related attitudes. A quality is considered subjective if its existence or instantiation depends on, or is constituted by, certain human responses; conversely, a quality is objective to the extent that its existence or instantiation is independent of such responses. Consequently, our knowledge of subjective qualities is often more direct, transparent, authoritative, and non-inferential than our knowledge of objective qualities, precisely due to this dependence.

Traditionally, secondary qualities have been regarded as almost entirely subjective, while primary qualities are viewed as objective. A secondary quality exists only because the perceivers are capable of perceiving or responding to it in a specific way, whereas a primary quality exists independently of perceivers. For example, an object’s being red is seen as subjective because it depends on how it appears to the observer, whereas being square-shaped is viewed as objective because it does not depend on an observer’s existence or perception.

Wright rejects this extreme dichotomy. According to Wright, his account shows that both primary and secondary qualities display degrees of subjectivity and objectivity. On one hand, the J-D account reveals that red is judgment-dependent: facts about redness are not constituted independently of human responses. On the other hand, this does not imply that “there is no standard to meet, that whatever we say about colour goes or — what comes to the same thing — that there is no such thing as an object’s real colour” (2001, 199). The fact that red is judgment-dependent does not entail that whatever seems right to the subject about color is right, that any judgment about color is correct. Rather, judgments about color are authoritative and extension-determining only when formed under the optimal conditions that include objective conditions, such as lighting, perceptual functioning, and cognitive conditions, all of which can be objectively assessed. Thus, certain states of affairs independent of the subject must obtain, and S’s judgments must be formed under those conditions for those judgments to reliably determine extensions.

In the case of square, by contrast, certain subjective criteria are also necessary: S must possess the concept of squareness, understand what it is for an object to have a shape, attend to the task, and be confident that relevant conditions obtain. These subjective requirements are crucial for S’s judgments to be reliable and to reflect the extension of the concept.

Traditionally, secondary qualities were dismissed as fully subjective and thus explanatorily irrelevant, as in Descartes’ view that secondary qualities should be excluded from a complete physical description of the world. Wright’s account challenges this view by demonstrating that, for a quality to count as secondary, certain objective conditions must obtain. Judgment-dependency itself relies on the existence and obtaining of objective states of affairs. Conversely, the judgment-independency of primary qualities depends, to some degree, on the subjective capacities of perceivers to recognize and apply concepts correctly. In this way, both primary and secondary qualities exhibit a mix of objectivity and subjectivity.

Nonetheless, the dependence of secondary or judgment-dependent qualities on human responses may appear to invite relativism: if facts about secondary qualities are constituted by subjects’ responses, these qualities might be seen as mere projections of human perception, akin to the expression of feelings or sensations. This raises concerns that if perception changes, the qualities themselves must also change. Must they?

6. Relativism, Objectivity, and Secondary Qualities

The worry here is that if color, for instance, is something that is dependent on one’s perception, then if the way one actually perceives the world changes, color must change as well: red would not be red anymore as it would not look red to the observer. Blackburn draws on this issue when considering analogies between moral values and secondary qualities (as proposed by John McDowell). For Blackburn, there is a crucial difference between secondary qualities, such as color, taste, and so forth, and the case of moral values: relativism, he argues, does not arise in the latter case. As he puts it, “the analogue with moral qualities fails dramatically: if everyone comes to think of it as permissible to maltreat animals, this does nothing at all to make it permissible: it just means that everybody has deteriorated” (1985, 14; see also Blackburn, 2013, 49-50).

If this is correct, moral judgments possess a form of objectivity that color judgments do not. However, not all philosophers agree that dependence on perception entails relativism about color.

Many instead argue that the extension of color concepts is determined by our actual responses under normal conditions. In this view, if an “inverted spectrum” scenario were to occur, where an alien intervention or a neurological change caused red to appear green and vice versa, this would not mean that the colors of objects themselves had changed, for instance, that grass would not be green anymore. At most, one can conclude that grass, or whatever was actually and originally green, merely appears red to them, not that its color has truly changed to red. As Sydney Shoemaker, the philosopher who introduced this thought experiment, explains, “green things look the way red things used to, yellow things look the way blue things used to, and so on” (Shoemaker, 1994, 302). This “rigidification” strategy preserves a useful sense of objectivity for secondary qualities: from the fact that red is a secondary quality and thus dependent on humans’ perception, it does not follow that objects would not really have a color. Rather, as Peter Railton formulates it, color would be related to our perception in the following way:

x is red = x is such as to elicit in normal humans as they actually are (and in actual normal circumstances) the visual impression of redness. (Railton, 1998, 132)

In this way, Railton disagrees that color concepts evoke relativism. He rather contends that color concepts enjoy a form of non-relativism or “objectivity” that the above equation conferred understood as “independence from certain changes in our attitudes or sensibilities” (1998, 133).

Railton’s position aligns with Wright’s view that, according to the Euthyphronic proposal, “it is the judgements of those who are actually statistically standard observers, in what are actually statistically standard conditions of observation, which count” (Wright, 1992, 114). If all people suddenly become color blind, they would obviously be disposed to make different judgments. Nonetheless, in such a counterfactual situation, our actual judgements, formed under standard conditions by standard observers, would still determine color facts: “Colours need not have changed; they need not have changed because the judgements which we would have made, had we still been visually constituted as we actually are, need not have changed” (1992, 114). Put differently, if in such a possible world people remained as they currently are, they would arrive at a judgment akin to the one they now hold. Thus, even for secondary qualities, judgment-dependency does not entail relativism but instead supports a qualified objectivity tied to the practices and capacities of actual observers under standard conditions.

This concludes our application of Wright’s J-D account to the cases of color and shape. This framework can now be employed to explore whether other concepts, particularly mental concepts and moral qualities, are best viewed as primary or secondary, or whether the analogy with primary and secondary qualities fails to illuminate their nature: a concept would be neither primary nor secondary if the account cannot be properly built for it. The following sections briefly outline how a J-D account might be developed for these more complex concepts.

7. Wright’s Account: The Case of Intention

What kind of concept is the concept of intention? To answer this, one can construct Wright’s J-D account for intention by (1) formulating a suitable PE for intention, (2) specifying the relevant optimal conditions, and (3) checking whether the A Priority, Substantiality, Independence, and Extremal Conditions are met.

Suppose that S intends to do j, such as go shopping. The PE for this case can be written as follows:

PE_INT: (x)(S): Optimal conditions obtain → (S intends to j ↔ S judges that S intends to j).

Here, the fact under consideration is that S has a particular intention, expressed in a self-ascription such as “I intend to go shopping.” This is an instance of avowal, where the subject ascribes a mental state to themself. The question is whether S’s own judgment constitutes the fact that they have this intention or determines the truth of their self-ascription.

Note that one can describe the relevant concepts, predicates, and qualities: taking S as an object, the quality in question is having the intention to go shopping, with the associated concept and the predicate “intends to go shopping.” This concept has a specific extension: only certain entities (humans) can instantiate it.

Since PE_INT concerns the subject’s judgment about their own intention, it represents a First-Personal J-D account: the same person or subject, whose intention is under scrutiny, is the judge too. An alternative would be a Third-Personal J-D account, where facts about S’s intention would be constituted by the judgments of another observer, or an interpreter, under optimal conditions (see Byrne, 1998; Child, 1994; Holton, 1992; Hossein Khani, 2023). The accounts considered in this article, including Wright’s, are first-personal.

In applying the J-D account to intention, Wright aims to answer two fundamental questions: (1) the metaphysical question of how the fact that S has the intention to do j is constituted, and (2) the epistemological question of how one can explain S’s direct and non-inferential knowledge of the content of their intention. If Wright’s J-D account successfully shows intention to be judgment-dependent, then facts about what S intends are constituted by S’s own judgments formed under optimal conditions, and S knows what they intend simply by forming a judgment under those conditions.

The next step is to specify the optimal conditions under which S can form their best judgment about their intention. Wright refers to these as “cognitively ideal conditions of both judge and circumstance” (Wright, 2001, 192), or “C-conditions.” In the case of intention, these naturally focus on the internal, cognitive functioning of S’s mind or brain. More particularly, Wright identifies three key conditions: “[a] grasp of the appropriate concepts, [a] lack of any material self-deception or anything relevantly similar, and [the] appropriate attentiveness” (2001, 201). These conditions are mostly clear: S must have the concept of intention, just as possessing the concept of redness was necessary for forming judgments about redness. Moreover, S must genuinely have the intention and not merely deceive themself into thinking so, avoiding distortions from intervening emotions, desires, or external pressures or environmental factors. Finally, S must be attentive to the question of their intention, not confusing it with hopes, fears, or other states. These conditions ensure that S’s judgment about their intention is reliable and can potentially play an extension-determining role.

Once PE_INT is formulated and the C-conditions specified, the next step is to evaluate whether PE_INT meets the A Priority, Substantiality, Independence, and Extremal conditions. First, the A Priority Condition.

If intention is a secondary concept, then the truth of PE_INT must be knowable a priori. PE_INT appears to satisfy this condition because possessing and reflecting on the concept of intention seems sufficient for subject S to recognize the truth of PE_INT: anyone who grasps the concept of intention would, under the specified C-conditions, judge that they have an intention if and only if they actually do, and knowledge of this would need no appeal to empirical experience.

As for the Substantiality Condition, a subtle problem emerges in relation to the second criterion.

a. Violation of the Substantiality Condition

The problem is that including conditions such as “S must not be self-deceived” would make PE_INT trivially true: this condition effectively requires that S not be in any situation that would prevent them from making correct judgments about their intention. However, the list of circumstances that might lead to self-deception is open-ended, and excluding all of them amounts to excluding all conditions under which S might be wrong about their intention.

As a result, the “no-self-deception” requirement functions as a “whatever-it-takes” condition, violating the Substantiality Condition: it ensures that S’s judgments are guaranteed to be correct under the C-conditions, regardless of whether the facts about intention are genuinely constituted by those judgments. This renders PE_INT trivially true and prevents intention from being classified as judgment-dependent under the J-D account.

Does this mean intention is judgment-independent? Wright argues that such a conclusion is drawn too hastily, suggesting that there may be a way to remove the problematic condition while preserving substantiality.

b. Self-Deception as a Positive Presumption

Wright proposes that this issue can be resolved by treating the “no-self-deception” condition as a positive presumption (see Wright, 2001, 202). This means treating the absence of self-deception as a default assumption in everyday communication and interpretation, grounded in the presumption that others are rational, language-using, and capable of thinking and possessing a rich set of propositional attitudes. The list of such things will go on and on, and these are linked to one another in a complex, holistic way. These assumptions about others are held by default, unless there is strong evidence to the contrary.

Dense “wholesale” self-deception would undermine a person’s rationality, but self-deception about a specific intention can often be detected through conflicts between self-ascriptions and actions. Interpreting others and being interpreted by others is necessary to detect such inconsistencies: one needs to be “an at least potential object of interpretation, with [their] claims about [their] own [intentions] essentially defeasible in the light of the shape assumed by [their] actual practice” (2001, 87).

If no inconsistencies are detectable, it is reasonable to positively presume that the no-self-deception condition holds (see 2001, 204). Doubt about self-deception arises only when there is strong evidence for it, and this allows the “no-self-deception” condition to be removed from the C-conditions. In this case, the C-conditions retrieve their substantiality: there is no condition providing S with whatever is necessary for a correct appraisal of intention. The problem of violating the Substantiality Condition is thus solved.

The resulting C-conditions, and consequently PE_INT, are restricted because the positive presumptive no-self-deception condition has been removed from the C-conditions. The resulting C-conditions are thus substantially specified but conditional on, or restricted to, the obtaining of the fact that there is no evidence in favor of any considerable self-deception. As Wright puts it, “if—lacking evidence to the contrary—we are a priori justified in holding the no-self-deception condition to be met, we are also a priori justified in believing the result of deleting that condition from the provisional biconditional in question” (2001, 202).

In this restricted form, PE_INT is no longer a priori true, but it is now “a priori reasonable to believe” that the restricted PE_INT is true: PE_INT is “a priori credible” (2002, 203). The truth of PE_INT is conditional upon the absence of evidence of self-deception, making it verifiably credible rather than unconditionally a priori.

Despite this restriction, Wright emphasizes, intention can still be regarded as judgment-dependent in a constructive sense. Of the three C-conditions (concept possession, attentiveness, absence of self-deception), the first two remain intact, while the third is handled as a defeasible presumption. Given that the A Priority, Substantiality, and Independence Conditions have been met, is there (for the sake of satisfying the Extremal Condition) any better explanation of why it is a priori reasonable to believe the truth of something like PE_INT?

For the Extremal Condition to be met, there must be no better explanation of the covariance between intention and judgment than the claim that S’s judgments formed under the restricted C-conditions play an extension-determining role. Wright argues that, “the key thought of the variant approach will be that the matter will be nicely explained if the concept of intention works in such a way that… S’s opinions, formed under the restricted set of C-conditions, play a defeasible extension-determining role. (2001, 203)

Thus, the best available explanation is that S’s judgments defeasibly determine the extension of the concept of intention, where “defeasibly” means that this extension-determining role can be overridden by evidence of self-deception. Therefore, intention is a defeasible judgment-dependent (secondary) concept.

Wright suggests that a similar treatment applies to the concept of meaning, which, like intention, sustains authoritative first-person avowals and exhibits “disposition-like theoreticity” (2001, 178, 206), that is, sensitivity to future disposed responses. In both cases, self-ascriptions (for instance, “I mean addition by ‘plus’”) are taken by default as reliable but remain defeasible in light of the subject’s future responses, dispositions, and practices.

The discussion of intention now naturally leads to the next case: moral values.

8. Wright’s Account: The Case of the Moral

Are moral values secondary qualities? One often thinks of good and bad, right and wrong, permissible and impermissible as moral qualities that certain human actions may instantiate: kicking a dog for fun is wrong, while kicking a rabid dog attacking a child is not. Can Wright’s J-D account explain what metaphysically determines the moral fact that an action has a particular moral quality, and how one come to know such facts? Is it S’s best judgment that determines the extension of concepts such as good, wrong, and permissible?

These questions form the core of meta-ethics, which typically divides into “cognitivism” (or sometimes “moral realism”) and “non-cognitivism.” Cognitivists hold that moral evaluations, such as “stealing that money was wrong,” express beliefs about actions. Beliefs have propositional content that are truth-apt, that is, capable of being true or false. If “stealing that money was wrong” is true, it is so because some moral fact obtains. Non-cognitivists, by contrast, argue that moral judgments merely express subjective sentiments rather than beliefs. Judgments such as “helping others is good” do not describe the world and thus have no truth-conditions; they are not truth-apt as there is no moral reality that makes them true or false. Such statements merely express one’s approval or disapproval of an action.

If it succeeds, the J-D account would offer a cognitivist, though not strongly realist, perspective: moral judgments would still be truth-apt, but their truth or falsity depends on human responses rather than on independently constituted moral facts (see Miller, 2003, 5–6, Chapter 7). As before, discussion begins by formulating a PE and specifying the C-conditions.

Wright’s example is the judgment that “That remark of Jones’s was culpably insensitive.” Contrary to the case of intention, Wright adopts a Third-Personal J-D account here because he is dealing with a performed action and judgments about that particular action; any suitable subject would, under the C-conditions, arrive at the same judgment:

PE_MORAL: (x)(S): The C-conditions obtain → (Jones’s remark was culpably insensitive ↔ S judges that Jones’s remark has been so).

In order to specify the C-conditions, one must see under what conditions S’s judgment about Jones’s remark would be their best judgment. The C-conditions, as before, have different parts: some would be about Jones, his personality, actions, thoughts, and life; some cover the features of the action itself; some concern the judge or S’s own moral capacities to form judgments about certain moral qualities. Wright offers the following C-conditions for the case at hand:

S scrutinises the motives, consequences and, for Jones, foreseeable consequences in the context of the remark; and does this in a fashion which involves no error concerning non-moral fact or logic, and embraces all morally-relevant considerations; and… S gives all this the fullest attention, and so is victim to no error or oversight concerning any relevant aspect of his/her deliberation; and… S is a morally-suitable subject – accepts the right moral principles, or has the right moral intuitions or sentiments, or whatever; and… S has no doubt about the satisfaction in any of these condition. (1988, 22-23)

Most conditions are straightforward, and there is enough justification to include them in the C-conditions. For, in order for S to judge whether Jones’s remark was culpably insensitive, S must evaluate what motivated Jones to do what he did, what consequences the action had, has, or would have for him and the targeted people, and so on. Moreover, S must take into account the context of the action, the environment, those who were present at the time, and other relevant factors carefully and accurately. In addition, in doing all this, S must not make any logical or non-moral factual errors.

The critical condition, however, is “S is a morally suitable subject,” requiring that S accept appropriate moral principles and possess fitting moral intuitions, ensuring S is qualified to judge others’ actions. A person who consistently behaves immorally would not be a reliable moral judge. For instance, to be eligible for making a reliable judgment, S must not themself make culpably insensitive remarks, and so forth. However, including the condition that S is a morally suitable subject in the C-conditions creates a serious difficulty. It results in a violation of both the Independence Condition and the Substantiality Condition.

First, any account or assessment of S’s moral suitability inevitably presupposes certain moral facts and knowledge of the extensions of certain moral concepts. If S lacks such knowledge, they cannot reliably judge whether Jones’s remark was culpably insensitive or whether certain actions are wrong. This presupposes the very moral facts that the J-D account aims to explain precisely via S’s judgments. How could S judge whether Jones’s remark was culpably insensitive if S does not know what actions fall under the concept of culpably insensitive actions? Thus, the Independence Condition is violated because of presupposing, in the C-conditions, facts about the extension of moral concepts.

This mirrors the earlier problem in the case of shape. There, requiring “shape stability” in the C-conditions presupposed the object’s shape, F, before S forms their best judgment to determine it. Similarly, requiring “moral suitability” presupposes that the action has a moral quality, M, already known by a morally suitable S before their judgment is formed, and this undermines the extension-determining role of S’s judgments.

Second, the suitability requirement implies that S is guaranteed to form correct moral judgments due to their possession of the necessary moral principles and intuitions. It becomes unclear under what conditions such a subject might fail to form correct judgments. Thus, the Substantiality Condition is also violated (see 1988, 23.)

Thus, including the “moral suitability requirement” in the C-conditions prevents the J-D account from showing that facts about the moral qualities of actions are constituted by S’s judgments under the specified conditions. Does this mean moral values are primary qualities, similar to shape?

a. Moral Values: Neither Primary nor Secondary

According to Wright, the analogy between moral values and secondary qualities such as color breaks down at a crucial point: meeting the C-conditions in the case of color does not require presupposing the extensions of color concepts, while “proper pedigree for moral judgements, by contrast, is a matter of meeting conditions the satisfaction of some of which is, irreducibly, a moral question” (1988, 23-24).

This disanalogy has significant consequences. In the case of moral qualities, one often wishes to preserve a degree of objectivity: for example, one regards the judgment that genocide is wrong as expressing more than a subjective sentiment; it is considered truly wrong, regardless of individual opinions.

For secondary qualities, Wright showed that S’s relevant judgments retain a sustainable objectivity despite their being secondary or judgment-dependent. However, since moral qualities are not analogous to secondary qualities, this helpful mix of objectivity and subjectivity is lost: “The mix of subjectivity and objectivity is simply not as in the case of secondary qualities. The comparison is misconceived, and can only encourage a misconceived confidence in the objectivity of morals” (1988, 24).

However, does this imply that moral qualities are primary qualities, like shape? Wright denies this analogy too. Primary qualities interact with other qualities of the object, as well as the perceiver, in various ways, but moral qualities “lack this diversity of interactive role” (1988, 25, fn. 36). Primary qualities, such as shape, extension, position, solidity, motion, and number, are those qualities by which one describes the fundamental nature of physical objects. Yet describing these qualities necessitates a network of interdependencies among them. For example, accounting for an object’s motion requires reference to its position; likewise, describing its size and shape involves its extension and solidity, among other attributes. According to Wright, such intricate interrelations and dependencies are absent in the realm of moral qualities.

Additionally, explanations of knowledge of primary qualities rely on such relationships and causal interactions. For instance, one may trace the covariance between the shape of an object and one’s (often very accurate) visual judgments of it to evolutionary processes and other natural factors. In the case of moral qualities, Wright argues, there is “no inkling of how such a story concerning our appraisal of moral value might run” (1988, 25, fn. 36). One does not know, or at least lack any plausible account of, which components of the body or brain might plausibly be cited to explain one’s purported epistemic access to moral facts. Do humans possess a distinct faculty, capacity, or mechanism uniquely designed to connect them to the alleged moral reality and deliver moral knowledge? The assumption of such special, perhaps even queer or mysterious, faculties is filled with well-known philosophical challenges.

In summary, unlike color, meaning, and intention, moral qualities cannot be viewed as secondary qualities, which means that the mix of objectivity and subjectivity they afford is lost. Yet moral qualities do not function as primary qualities either. From these considerations, Wright concludes that appealing to the distinction between primary and secondary qualities offers no constructive path for the metaphysics and epistemology of the moral. The moral cannot be located within this framework, requiring philosophers to look elsewhere for an account of moral values.

In this way, Wright’s J-D account demonstrates that the comparison between secondary and primary qualities and moral qualities is flawed. This still is an important philosophical insight.

9. References and Further Reading

a. References

Blackburn, Simon. 1985. “Errors and the Phenomenology of Value.” In Morality and Objectivity: A Tribute to J.L. Mackie, edited by Ted Honderich, 1–22. London: Routledge.
Blackburn, Simon. 1993. “Circles, Finks, Smells and Biconditionals.” Philosophical Perspectives, 7: 259–279.
Blackburn, Simon. 2013. “Relativism.” In The Blackwell Guide to Ethical Theory, edited by Hugh LaFollette, 43–58. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
Byrne, Alex. 1998. “Interpretivism.” European Review of Philosophy, 3: 199–223.
Child, William. 1994. Causality, Interpretation, and the Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Cooper, John M. (ed.). 1997. Plato: Complete Works. Indianapolis: Hackett. Euthyphro: 1–16.
Holton, Richard. 1991. “Intentions, Response-Dependence, and Immunity from Error.” ANU Working Papers in Philosophy, 1: 1–26.
Holton, Richard. 1992. “Response-Dependence and Infallibility.” Analysis, 52(3): 180–184.
Hossein Khani, Ali. 2023. “Intention and Judgment-Dependence: First-Personal vs. Third-Personal Accounts.” Philosophical Explorations, 27(1): 41–56.
Jackson, Frank. 1996. “The Primary Quality View of Color.” Noûs, 30: 199–219.
Jackson, Frank and Pettit, Philip. 2002. “Response-Dependence without Tears.” Philosophical Issues, 12: 97–117.
Johnston, Mark. 1989. “Dispositional Theories of Value.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 63: 139–74.
Johnston, Mark. 1992. “How to Speak of the Colors.” Philosophical Studies, 68: 221–263.
Johnston, Mark. 1993. “Objectivity Refigured: Pragmatism Without Verificationism.” In Reality, Representation and Projection, edited by John Haldane and Crispin Wright, 85–130. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Johnston, Mark. 1998. “Are Manifest Qualities Response-Dependent?”. The Monist, 81(1): 3–43.
McDowell, John. 1985. “Values and Secondary Qualities.” In Morality and Objectivity: A Tribute to J. L. Mackie, edited by Ted Honderich, 110–129. London: Routledge.
Miller, Alexander. 2003. An Introduction to Contemporary Metaethics. Cambridge, MA: Blackwell
Pettit, Philip. 1991. “Realism and Response-Dependence.” Mind, 100(400): 586–626.
Pettit, Philip. 1998. “Terms, Things and Response-Dependence.” European Review of Philosophy, 3: 55–66.
Railton, Peter. 1998. “Red, Bitter, Good.” European Review of Philosophy, 3: 67–84.
Shoemaker, Sidney. 1994. “Self-Knowledge and ‘Inner Sense’.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 54: 249–314.
Wedgwood, Ralph. 2013. “Concepts vs. Properties, Moral.” In The International Encyclopedia of Ethics, edited by Hugh LaFollette, 976–984. London: John Wiley & Sons.
Wright, Crispin. 1988. “Moral Values, Projection and Secondary qualities.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society. 62: 1–26.
Wright, Crispin. 1992. Truth and Objectivity. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Wright, Crispin. 1993. Realism, Meaning and Truth. Second Edition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Wright, Crispin. 2001. Rails to Infinity: Essays on Themes from Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Wright, Crispin. 2012. “Replies.” In Mind, Meaning, and Knowledge: Themes from the Philosophy of Crispin Wright, edited by Annalisa Coliva, 377–486. Oxford: Oxford University Press.

b. Further Reading

Boghossian, Paul. 2012. “Blind Rule-Following.” In Mind, Meaning, and Knowledge: Themes from the Philosophy of Crispin Wright, edited by Annalisa Coliva, 27–48. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Boghossian, Paul and J. David Velleman. 1989. “Colour as a Secondary Quality.” Mind, 98(389): 81–103.
Brynjarsdóttir, Eyja M. 2008. “Response-Dependence of Concepts Is Not for Properties.” American Philosophical Quarterly, 45(4): 377–386.
Devitt, Michael. 2009. “Global Response Dependency and Worldmaking.” In Putting Metaphysics First, 121–136. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Edwards, Jim. 1992a. “Secondary Qualities and the A Priori.” Mind, 101(402): 263–272.
Edwards, James. 1992b. “Best Opinion and Intentional States.” Philosophical Quarterly, 42 (166): 21–33.
Haukioja, Jussi 2001. “The Modal Status of Basic Equations.” Philosophical Studies, 104: 115–122.
Haukioja, Jussi. 2007. “How (Not) to Specify Normal Conditions for Response-Dependent Concepts.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 85(2): 325–331.
Hindriks, Frank A. 2006. “Acceptance-Dependence: A Social Kind of Response-Dependence.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 87(4): 481–498.
Hossein Khani, Ali. 2020. “Interpretationism and Judgement-Dependence.” Synthese, 198(10): 9639-9659.
Hossein Khani, Ali. 2023. “Intention, Judgment-Dependence, and Self-Deception.” Res Philosophica, 100(2): 203–226.
Jackson, Frank. 1996. “The Primary Quality View of Color.” Noûs, 30: 199–219
Menzies, Peter and Price, Huw. 1993. “Causation as a Secondary Quality.” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 44(2): 187–203.
Miller, Alexander. 2007. “Another Objection to Wright’s Treatment of Intention.” Analysis, 67 (3): 257–263.
Miller, Alexander. 2009. “Primary Qualities, Secondary Qualities and the Truth about Intention.” Synthese 171 (3): 433–442.
Miller, Alexander and Divers, John. 1994. “Best Opinion, Intention-Detecting and Analytic Functionalism.” Philosophical Quarterly, 44(175): 239–245.
Norris, Christopher. 2002. “Realism, Projectivism and Response-Dependence: On the Limits of ‘Best Judgement’.” Philosophy and Social Criticism, 28(2):123–152.
Pettit, Philip. 1999. “A Theory of Normal and Ideal Conditions.” Philosophical Studies, 96: 21–44.
Powell, Mark. 1998. “Realism or Response Dependence?”. European Review of Philosophy, 3: 1–13.
Railton, Peter. 1998. “Aesthetic Value, Moral Value, and the Ambitions of Naturalism.” In Aesthetics and Ethics: Essays at the Intersection, edited by Jerrold Levinson, 59–105. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Stroud, Barry. 2018. “Are the Colours of Things Secondary Qualities?” In Seeing, Knowing, Understanding, 179–192. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Shoemaker, Sydney. 1990. “Qualities and Qualia: What’s in the Mind?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 50: 109–131.
Thompson, Brad. 2006. “Moral Value, Response-Dependence, and Rigid Designation.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 36(1): 71–94.

Author Information

Ali Hossein Khani
Email: hosseinkhani@irip.ac.ir
Iranian Institute of Philosophy
Iran

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy