Sarvāstivāda Buddhism

The Sarvāstivāda school of Indian Buddhism emerged from the attempts of early Buddhist communities to systematise the teachings of the Buddha into a complete and consistent description of reality. This often took the form of reducing our phenomenal experience of reality to the atomic, mind-independent fundamental constituents—known as dharmas—from which the mind constructs the objects of everyday experience. By understanding the mind-independent world, one is better equipped to achieve the goal of the Buddhist system—the cessation of suffering (i.e. Nirvana). What distinguished the Sarvāstivāda from these other schools was their claim that the fundamental elements (dharmas) were permanently existing, a point of major contention with other schools of Buddhism. Despite these issues, the Sarvāstivāda provided a framework for the Buddha’s teachings that was utilised by other Buddhists, even their opponents, and the school successfully merged the philosophical and analytic aspects of Buddhist teaching with the broader ethical and soteriological goals of the system. This article begins by discussing the origins of the early schools of Buddhism in the attempt to interpret the teachings of the Buddha, and it highlights the key texts and thinkers of the Sarvāstivāda school. The article then presents the metaphysical picture defended by the Sarvāstivāda school, explaining the method of reduction used to distinguish between conceptually constructed entities (prajñapti-sat) and the fundamental mind-independent dharmas (dravya-sat), the role of intrinsic nature (svabhāva) in this method, the arguments that led the Sarvāstivāda to its characteristic claim for the permanent existence of dharmas, and the school’s understanding of causality as applied to dharmas. The process of categorising dharmas is then discussed, specifically the five-fold categorisation of the 75 dharma types, as developed by the Sarvāstivāda school. Given that the Buddhist outlook is concerned with liberation from existential suffering, the article also considers the role of Sarvāstivāda thought with regard to this goal, from its understanding of liberation as the cessation of dharmas in a particular stream and the function of defilements in this account of suffering. Finally, the article touches upon criticisms of the Sarvāstivāda position by the Sautrāntika, Madhyamaka, and Yogacāra schools.

Table of Contents

1. Historical Context
   1. The Buddha’s Teachings and the Early Schools
   2. Early Buddhist Texts and the Abhidharma
   3. The Sarvāstivāda and Their Texts
2. The Metaphysics of the Sarvāstivāda
   1. Dharmas (An Account of the Reductionist Method)
   2. Intrinsic Nature (svabhāva) as the Mark of Ultimate Reality
   3. The Existence of Dharmas at all Times (sarva asti)
   4. Causation Between Dharmas (The hetu-pratyaya Model)
3. The Ontology of the Sarvāstivāda (The Categorisation of Dharmas)
   1. Matter (rūpa)
   2. Thought (citta)
   3. Mental Concomitants (caitta/caitasika)
   4. Conditioned Dharmas Separate from Thought (citta-viprayukta-saṃskāra)
   5. Unconditioned Dharmas (asaṃskṛta)
4. Dharma Theory as a Means to Liberation
5. Criticisms of the Sarvāstivāda
   1. Sautrāntika Criticism of Ontological Promiscuity and the Tri-Temporal Existence of Dharmas
   2. Madhyamaka Criticisms of Intrinsic Nature (svabhāva) as Incompatible with Dependent-Origination (pratītya-samutpāda)
   3. Yogacāra Criticism of Material Atomism
6. Conclusion
7. References and Further Reading
   1. Translations of Sanskrit Texts
   2. Secondary Literature

1. Historical Context

a. The Buddha’s Teachings and the Early Schools

The Buddha (the “awakened” one) was born around the 5th century B.C.E. as Siddhārtha Gautama and, after spending time meditating as a renunciant, he reached enlightenment. He then proceeded to share his knowledge and teachings with disciples who formed the earliest Buddhist community.

Like other Indian philosophers of the time, the Buddha accepted a number of metaphysical views about the world. The first of these was that when a person dies, they are reborn as another being. This is seen as unpleasant, and the goal of practice is to gain liberation from this cycle of rebirth. A person is not always reborn as a human being, but may be reborn as a non-human animal, or even an insect. The kind of thing one is reborn as is determined by the law of karma-phala (“action-result”). Virtuous actions and intentions accrue good karma, which leads to rebirth in a higher state, but bad intentions and actions lead to rebirth in a lower state.

The teachings of the Buddha emerged with the above presuppositions. His teachings are varied, but the whole is often conveyed through the “Four Noble Truths,” derived from the first sermon he gave upon reaching enlightenment. These are:

(1) The truth of existential suffering

(2) The truth that suffering has a cause

(3) The truth that suffering has an end

(4) The truth that there is a path to end suffering

For the Buddha, the world and everything within it were seen to be impermanent, and this led to the feeling of suffering. This suffering is existential since it is inherent in our existence. The truth that we, our loved ones, the things we desire to possess, and the pleasures we feel are all impermanent is the basis for a feeling of dissatisfaction and anguish in life. This is considered to be self-evident to anybody who reflects, and the realisation of it is what leads one to consider a spiritual life.

The second truth provides an explanation for the suffering and, importantly, shows that suffering arises in dependence upon certain conditions. These conditions are our instinctive nature to crave or thirst after things, a tendency which is rooted in our desire for things we find pleasurable, our aversion to those we find painful, and our delusion at the way things really are—specifically the delusion that there is a permanently enduring self.

The truth that suffering has an end claims that if the above conditions are removed, then existential suffering is also removed. If craving is blocked, one is less inclined to intend or commit acts which lead to rebirth, and this will prevent rebirth. The state in which craving is absent is Nirvana, and upon death, one reaches “Complete Nirvana”—the cessation of rebirth.

The truth that there is a path to end suffering claims that there is a way to reach Nirvana that is understandable, communicable and attainable. It is referred to as the “Noble Eightfold Path” and is a combination of knowledge, action, and cultivation. The eight elements of the path consist of right view, right thought, right speech, right action, right livelihood, right effort, right mindfulness, and right concentration.

Returning to the second truth, and the delusion that leads to suffering, one of the defining features of the Buddha’s thought is the claim that there is no permanently enduring self. In place of this, the Buddha claimed that what was thought to be the self was merely an erroneous superimposition upon a series of impersonal elements called skandhas. These consist of matter, emotions, cognitions, volitions, and consciousness. These were sufficient to explain our experience in the world, and there was no need to posit a permanently enduring self over and above these. Even worse, the positing of a self-perpetuated suffering. If one believes oneself to be a permanently enduring self, then it would be possible for that enduring entity to acquire possessions. But the possessions one desires are impermanent, and so one will inevitably suffer when they perish. In addition, if one posits a self, then one identifies with something in the world called a “self.” But if everything that exists is impermanent, this includes the self. This means the experience of old age, suffering, and death, once again leading to existential suffering. The role of the illusion of the self in Buddhist thought is concisely captured in a passage from the Buddhist scriptures (Saṃyutta Nikāya 22):

And how does grasping lead to anxiety? It’s when an uneducated ordinary person regards form [i.e. physical matter] like this: ‘This is mine, I am this, this is my self.’ But that form of theirs decays and perishes, which gives rise to sorrow, lamentation, pain, sadness, and distress. (Saṃyutta Nikāya translated by Bhikku Sujato)

Thus, for the Buddha, the belief in a self is intimately tied to ignorance and suffering.

Another teaching closely related to the second and third Noble Truths is that of “dependent-origination” (pratītya-samutpāda). Though developed in different ways, the core of its philosophical aspect rests on the claim that everything that exists does so as a result of causes, and that anything that ceases to exist does so as a result of the removal of its causes. This formulation is notably stated in the Saṃyutta Nikāya (12.61), a discourse in which the Buddha states the following:

When this exists, that comes to be; with the arising of this, that arises. When this does not exist, that does not come to be; with the cessation of this, that ceases. (Translated by Bhikku Bodhi, n.d.)

It is this concept of “dependent-origination” that provides a metaphysical basis for the claim that everything is impermanent (since everything depends upon its causes), that suffering has a cause, and that there is an end to suffering (through the removal of its causes). This notion became increasingly important as Buddhist metaphysics continued to develop, as shall be seen below.

b. Early Buddhist Texts and the Abhidharma

After the Buddha’s death, his disciples gathered to solidify his teachings into an authoritative collection. These were initially transmitted orally but eventually written down. One of the earliest such written collections that survives is the Pali Canon of the Theravāda Buddhists of Sri Lanka. These are divided into three sections, or “baskets” (piṭaka), a practice of organisation followed by most other early Buddhist schools. The first of these is the basket of discourses (sūtra), and it contains a vast collection of narrative episodes in which the Buddha imparted his teachings to others, such as the examples given above relating to the Four Noble Truths and dependent-origination.

The second section includes detailed rules and regulations pertaining to monastic discipline. Whilst Buddhist schools were often tolerant of differing philosophical views, the monastic rules were closely guarded, and any attempt to alter these was seen as grounds for removal from the Buddhist community. In an important episode in early Buddhist history, a dispute involving such rules led to a split between two groups: the Sthavira Nikāya (“the group of elders”) and the Mahāsāṃghika (“the greater community”). Both of these groups continued to split into smaller schools over time, and it was from the former that the Sarvāstivāda school eventually emerged.

The final basket is the “Abhidharma,” and it contains texts which appear to be of a later date than the other two baskets. These texts attempt to systematise the teachings of the Buddha by cataloguing and organising the constituents of reality referenced in the discourses (the first basket), such as the elements that generate the illusion of a permanently enduring self. Any inconsistencies between the Buddha’s statements were explained away by reference to the doctrine of “two-truths” (dvaya-satya), the claim that the Buddha, from his compassion to spread the teachings of how to achieve liberation, would adjust his manner of speaking to meet the intellectual stage of his hearer. In this way, the Buddha’s remarks may not correspond to the way the world actually was, but were merely a pragmatic way of speaking to help someone reach the next stage on the path. When the Buddha spoke in this way, it was held that he was speaking the “conventional truth” (saṃvṛti-satya). When he was held to be describing objective reality, his statements were said to correspond to the “ultimate truth” (paramārtha-satya). It is the Abhidharma basket that is believed to contain this ultimate truth, and its texts are written in the form of lists or “matrices” (mātṛkā) of the basic elements of reality according to different arrangements and categories. Many are also written in the form of a catechism, proving useful to monks for memorisation. The Abhidharma texts are mainly descriptive, and it was left to later Buddhist philosophers to philosophically defend the account of reality found in these texts. Those monks who are specialists in the Abhidharma texts and who offer a defence of its metaphysics are often referred to as “Ābhidharmika.” There are, however, major differences between these Ābhidharmika, leading to a variety of philosophical schools, with one of these schools being the Sarvāstivāda.

c. The Sarvāstivāda and Their Texts

Much of the history of the Sarvāstivāda school is shrouded in mystery. It is believed that the school emerged from the earlier Sthavira Nikāya (“the group of elders”) of the Buddhist community. The school was especially prominent in the North West of ancient India, in Central Asia, and in Kashmir. Their arguments for the permanent existence of basic elements through time and their claim that these elements possessed an intrinsic nature (svabhāva) proved controversial, becoming a source of much disagreement within Buddhist philosophical circles.

The three baskets of the Sarvāstivāda survive in ancient translations into Chinese and Tibetan, although several Sanskrit texts from their sūtra basket have also been discovered. The Abhidharma basket of the Sarvāstivāda consists of seven texts: (i) the Dharmaskandha, (ii) the Saṃgītiparyāya, (iii) the Prajñapti, (iv) the Vijñānakāya, (v) the Prakaraṇa, (vi) the Dhātukāya, and (vii) the Jñānaprasthāna. A very significant commentary on these texts, known as the “Great Commentary” (Mahāvibhāṣā), came to be seen as the most coherent and comprehensive formulation of the Sarvāstivāda, collecting the arguments of different Sarvāstivāda teachers. This text was of such significance to the Sarvāstivāda school in Kashmir that the group was given the name Vaibhāṣikas, meaning “those of the commentary.” The Mahāvibhāṣā was extensively drawn upon by later Sarvāstivāda writers, and two particularly important philosophers who utilised and developed the arguments found in this commentary deserve mention: Vasubandhu and Saṃghabhadra.

The renowned Buddhist philosopher Vasubandhu, attracted by the prestige of the Sarvāstivāda school in Kashmir, studied with them and eventually composed the extremely influential “Treasury of Abhidharma” (Abhidharmakośa), which still survives in its original Sanskrit. It appears that during the composition of this text, he began to doubt the arguments of the Kashmiri Sarvāstivādins, and his commentary to the text (the Abhidharmakośa-bhāṣya) offers a range of criticisms of their doctrines. The brilliance of his text is reflected in the fact that it continued to be used by the Sarvāstivāda monks even after Vasubandhu became a critic of the school.

Saṃghabhadra was a philosopher of the Kashmiri Sarvāstivāda school, and he sought to defend their teachings against the criticisms of Vasubandhu. He wrote two influential texts—the Nyāyānusāra and the Abhidharmasamayapradīpikā—which only survive in early Chinese translations, and display a maturation and sophistication of the doctrines found in the earlier texts.

2. The Metaphysics of the Sarvāstivāda

The Sarvāstivāda school provided a detailed account of reality as consisting of permanently existing and causally interacting basic elements. To defend this model, they developed a method of metaphysical reduction, introduced a concept of a permanent intrinsic nature (svabhāva), offered arguments for their claim that these basic elements existed permanently, and provided a scheme of categorisation based on the causal roles of these elements. This section covers each of these features of Sarvāstivāda thought.

a. Dharmas (An Account of the Reductionist Method)

The Sarvāstivāda, along with the other Abhidharma schools, followed the Buddha in his reductionist project. But where the Buddha had simply reduced the self (and phenomena like cognition) into its constituent elements, claiming that the self was an illusion, the Sarvāstivāda went much further and applied this methodology to the whole of phenomenal experience and the external world. Everything, from concrete objects like pots to mental phenomena like thoughts, was to be reduced to their fundamental elements. This led to an ontological distinction between those entities that could not be reduced further, and therefore truly existed, and those that were reducible but perceived as real by a mind polluted with ignorance. The Sarvāstivāda essentially split the world into really existing ultimate elements, which they called “dharmas,” and those illusory entities built up from dharmas. Something existing on the level of dharmas was referred to as a “substantial entity” (dravya-sat), whereas that which was constructed from the dharmas, and erroneously perceived as real, was referred to as a “designated entity” (prajñapti-sat), the latter implying that the belief in these unreal entities results from our concepts and conventional use of language. These two ontological levels corresponded to the two levels of truth adopted by Buddhists in interpreting the Buddha’s statements. If there were any inconsistency in the Buddha’s remarks, one would look for whether the statement was a description of ultimate reality (paramārtha-satya) or a pragmatic use of the usual way people speak of the world when they are imbued with ignorance (saṃvṛti–satya). If the former, then the Buddha was speaking of dravya-sat entities (i.e. dharmas); if not, then he was speaking of prajñapti-sat entities.

Having adopted a two-tier ontology, the Sarvāstivāda needed to explain a way of determining which tier a given entity belonged to—an account of the reductive methodology had to be given. The Buddhist philosopher Vasubandhu, in the Abhidharmakośabhāsya (6.4), gives a concise statement of the approach adopted by the Sarvāstivāda:

Where a cognition of an object, by division or by abstraction, turns into something else, like water or a pot, then it is an [unreal] conventional entity (saṃvṛtisat); otherwise it is a [real] ultimate entity (paramārthasat).

Vasubandhu elaborates on this definition further. He states that sometimes a cognition of an object ceases when that object is broken into parts. Consider a pot. Once the pot is broken into parts, we no longer have a cognition of a pot, but a cognition of potsherds. The pot is, therefore, a conventional entity—ultimately unreal. We perceive it to exist due to our conventions, way of living, and our linguistic practices. But there are certain aspects of cognition that remain, even when the pot is broken into pieces. The cognition of colour and shape, for example, will remain, even if the potsherds are further broken. If these cannot be divided further without cognition ceasing, then they are to be taken as ultimately real entities (dharmas). This is the method of reduction by division.

Vasubandhu also suggests a form of reduction via abstraction. As previously mentioned, the Sarvāstivāda wished to apply their reductive method to all phenomenal experience, and the method of reduction by division only applies to physical objects. It is interesting to note that of the five elements (skandhas) to which the Buddha reduced the self, only one of them is physical matter (rūpa), with the other four being related to mental phenomena. As such, the Sarvāstivāda need an additional method of reduction to capture these entities. Vasubandhu describes reduction by abstraction as occurring when “the other things have been abstracted by thought and the cognition of the original entity does not arise.” He means that when we abstract different aspects of an entity and focus on these aspects, the experience no longer includes that original entity. We continue this until we can no longer abstract further without the cognitive experience ceasing. In terms of a pot, this would involve mentally abstracting different aspects from the pot to determine whether, in the absence of these aspects, the cognition of a pot still arises. So, for example, if we abstract and focus on colour, or shape, or resistance to touch, these are no longer a cognition of the pot, yet it seems we cannot go any further in our abstraction without the cognitive experience ceasing. It appears that all forms of reduction by division are included in reduction by abstraction, but not the reverse. For example, cognitive experiences cannot be broken like a pot, yet through abstraction one may determine the constituent elements of a given cognition, such as the eye, the pot, the thought that one is looking at a pot, and the emotional colouring of the cognition if one needs a pot (though this may sound obscure, section 3 of this article covers the Sarvāstivāda categorisation of dharmas, such as those that constitute a cognition). It appears that all forms of reduction by division may also be accomplished through reduction by abstraction, but not the reverse.

In the process of both forms of reduction, we eventually land on a certain quality that stands independently. These qualities are what explain and define the macro-objects that are built from them. In understanding what a pot is, we refer to its features of colour, shape, and resistance to touch. The pot derives its nature from these aspects, and yet these aspects stand independently. They contain a nature that is not borrowed from anything else—an intrinsic nature. It is from this logic that we land on another key component of the Sarvāstivāda metaphysics: svabhāva.

b. Intrinsic Nature (svabhāva) as the Mark of Ultimate Reality

The Sarvāstivāda did not simply wish to offer a reductive methodology, but they sought to exhaustively catalogue our phenomenal experience and the external world. If one understands one’s own experiences and the world, as they truly are, devoid of the distorting effects of ignorance, then one is better placed to attain spiritual liberation. In order to catalogue, the Sarvāstivāda needed a method of categorisation. The early Abhidharma schools experimented with a number of methods of categorisation, but the Sarvāstivāda eventually settled on grouping dharmas by the quality they could never be without. Combined with the reductive method detailed above, this meant that dharmas would possess only a single intrinsic nature, providing a strictly delineated categorisation. If it appeared that there was more than one intrinsic nature for a dharma, then the reduction had not been fully completed. Furthermore, rather than adopt a form of categorisation based on one dharma’s relation to another (such that one type dharma may have the nature of being colder than another type of dharma), the reliance on an intrinsic nature provided an atemporal grouping, one that was not liable to fluctuate in the way a categorisation based on relational qualities might (such that one dharma has the nature of being colder when compared to a second dharma, but hotter when compared to a third). More detail on the categories decided upon by the Sarvāstivāda is detailed in Section 3 of this article.

The svabhāva, therefore, is something a dharma possesses. Given classical Indian philosophers’ penchant for etymological derivations for the meaning of concepts, Vasubandhu states that the etymology of “dharma” derives from “its bearing (dhāraṇa), its unique characteristic (svalakṣaṇa—a term often synonymous with svabhāva).” This svabhāva provides the unreal entities we mistakenly take as real, those that are built from dharmas, their specific qualities and nature. These conventionally real but ultimately unreal entities (saṃvṛti-sat/prajñapti-sat) are said to possess an external nature (parabhāva) that is derived from the svabhāva of dharmas. In contrast, a svabhāva is intrinsic to a dharma, and does not depend for its nature on any other entity.

It is useful at this point to note that whilst each numerically distinct dharma had its own numerically distinct svabhāva, the categorisation groups these separate svabhāva by kind. There is, therefore, a token-svabhāva and a type-svabhāva. The categorisation of dharmas, by their svabhāva, offers an account of the latter. The token-svabhāva fulfils a metaphysical role in the Sarvāstivāda account of reality.

Though the Sarvāstivāda contributed to developments in the Buddhist method of reduction and categorisation, and set the notion of svabhāva as foundational in their metaphysics, their lasting and most controversial contribution is the position that gives the school its name—that the dharmas (and their svabhāva) are eternal and fixed, that is, they exist at all times (sarvam asti).

c. The Existence of Dharmas at all Times (sarva asti)

There appears to be no logical necessity for a given dharma to exist permanently, even if one were to grant it a svabhāva. It seems that one can consistently hold that there are irreducible elements that possess a single independent nature, and that these elements can also come into and out of existence (along with their essence). But the Sarvāstivāda made the additional leap of claiming that a dharma existed in the “three times”—in the past, in the present, and in the future. The motivation for this is the same as that which always motivates the Sarvāstivāda: a desire to systematise the Buddha’s teachings into a single coherent metaphysical picture. As such, the arguments for the tri-temporal existence of dharmas are a combination of appeals to the literature of the tradition and logical reasoning. Vasubandhu, in his Abhidharmakośa, provides four arguments. The first and second are presented as appeals to authoritative literature, and the third and fourth as a result of logical reasoning. The arguments are as follows:

(i) The tri-temporal existence of dharmas is supported by scripture.

In explaining this argument, Vasubandhu refers to a discourse of the Buddha in which the latter states that, should past dharmas not exist, monks could not take them (the past) into consideration, and, if future dharmas did not exist, monks could not delight in them (the future). If the tri-temporal existence of dharmas is false, then so is the Buddha’s claim. Whilst the argument is stated as an appeal to authoritative literature, an underlying reason for the claim can be found in the third argument.

(ii) The tri-temporal existence of dharmas is supported by the Buddha’s account of cognition.

The Buddha’s account of cognition held that, rather than there being a self that does the cognising, cognition simply consists of six sense-faculties, each of which has its own sphere of operation, the combination of which produces a particular type of cognition. So, a visual experience is the result of the sense-faculty (the eye) coming into contact with a visible object. The reason this entails the tri-temporal existence of dharmas is that the Sarvāstivāda thought that past and future dharmas could be sense-objects, as one can think of both the past and the future. Therefore, if the Buddha’s words are correct, the tri-temporal existence of dharmas must be accepted. Once again, the argument is presented as an appeal to authoritative literature, but the following argument seems to provide further reasoning for the claim in the scripture.

(iii) The tri-temporal existence of dharmas is supported by the fact that consciousness always has a real object.

The Sarvāstivāda hold that all mental activity is intentional—it has an object that it is about, and that object must exist for consciousness to occur. If past and future dharmas do not exist, then one cannot have any cognitions involving a past or future object. But we do have such cognitions—one can think of the cake one ate last week, or the trip one plans to take next month. From this, the Sarvāstivāda argue that if the tri-temporal existence of dharmas is denied, and past and future dharmas do not exist, we would have to conclude that consciousness can have an unreal object. But if we have consciousness of it, it must be real. Therefore, past and future dharmas exist from the intentional structure of cognition.

(iv) The tri-temporal existence of dharmas is supported by the fact that the past has a result in the present.

The Sarvāstivāda argue that if we believe actions to have consequences, then we must grant actions causal power. But most actions (which the Sarvāstivāda also reduce to dharmas) are in the past, especially when their consequences manifest. In order to make sense of this, we ought to accept that past dharmas exist, and it is through this continued existence that they are able to causally influence the present and the future. This reasoning also fits well with the Buddhist commitment to the framework of karma-phala—the pan-Indian belief that all intentional actions have consequences, the latter of which depend on the moral status of the intention.

If one accepts that dharmas exist in the past, present, and future, and also accepts that dharmas possess an unchanging intrinsic nature, then an account should be given for why we perceive these three temporal states. Why does there appear to be a difference between the past, present, and future, if the dharma itself does not change? But more importantly, if some notion of change is not included within the Sarvāstivāda metaphysics, then it seems to dismiss the Buddha’s claim that reality is characterised by impermanence. And if all is permanent and unchangeable, one cannot make sense of the possibility of religious liberation, for surely this involves a change from non-liberated to liberated.

The Mahāvibhāṣā and Vasubandhu’s Abhidharmakośa refer to four approaches in explaining the nature of temporal change by historic teachers of the Sarvāstivāda as follows:

(a) Dharmatrāta: the difference between the times is a difference of being (bhāva-anyathātva)

Dharmatrāta argues that whilst a dharma retains its substance permanently, it changes its mode of being, and it is the change of mode of being that accounts for temporal difference. He compares this to a golden vessel, where its substance as a material form of gold remains even whilst the shape may change if it is melted down and remoulded. The intrinsic nature (svabhāva) of a dharma is like the gold substance, and the different times are like the different shapes the gold may be moulded into. In this way, a dharma is both permanent and yet undergoes change. Vasubandhu finds this argument unsatisfactory—if a mode of being is treated like a quality that inheres in an underlying permanent dharma, then in altering its qualities, the dharma also changes (Gold: 29-31). The error of this approach is compared to the non-Buddhist Sāṃkhya school of Indian philosophy, and their doctrine of transformation (parināma), according to which cause and effect are merely the transformation of an underlying substance. The Sāṃkhya position implies that change is not, therefore, the coming into existence or falling out of existence of entities, contradicting the Buddha’s claim of universal impermanence (Although see Dhammajoti (137-138) for a defence of Dharmatrāta).

(b) Ghoṣaka: the difference between the times is a difference of characteristic (lakṣaṇa- anyathātva)

Ghoṣaka claims, like Dharmatrāta, that the substance of a dharma (its intrinsic nature/svabhāva) remains the same, yet it alters in its temporal “character.” Importantly, Ghoṣaka proposes that whilst a dharma is connected to one temporal characteristic (for example, the past), it is not severed from the other temporal characteristics (such as the present and the future). A dharma is always connected to the three different temporal periods, only to varying degrees. He likens this to the desire a man may have for a woman, in that it is compatible with the man simultaneously desiring other women, even though the desire is for the time focused upon the first woman. In this way, Ghoṣaka can avoid the kind of criticism that was raised against Dharmatrāta, since for Ghoṣaka, a dharma never loses the characteristics of past, present, and future, therefore maintaining its status as permanent. The problem with this approach, according to Vasubandhu, is that this does not do enough to distinguish the three times—if a dharma always, in fact, possesses the characteristic of past, present, and future, then what is there to distinguish the three times? Returning to Ghoṣaka’s example, even though the man’s desire is focused on a particular woman, Vasubandhu argues that, according to Ghoṣaka’s reasoning, the man would in fact always desire all of the women. Potential (the future) and enactment (the present) are the same (Gold: 32). Temporal difference is left unexplained.

(c) Buddhadeva: the difference between the times is a difference of relation to the other times (anyathā-anyathātva)

Buddhadeva tried to solve the issue by proposing that the terms “past,” “present,” and “future” are predicated of dharmas by reference to those that precede and those that follow them. So, a particular dharma may be “past” relative to a second dharma, and yet “future” relative to a third. The substance of the dharma remains the same—it does not change its intrinsic nature (svabhāva). The only change is its relation to other dharmas, and these relations account for the difference between the time periods. Buddhadeva gives the example of the same woman who is called “daughter” relative to her mother, and “mother” relative to her child. The woman does not change her substance, merely her relation to the other people differs. Vasubandhu criticises this position on the basis that it, too, fails to provide an adequate account of the differences between the three temporal periods. Just as the same woman can be both a mother and a daughter, the same dharma can then be past, present, and future. But the time periods are themselves defined in distinction to one another; they are supposed to be mutually exclusive, and so the account fails (Gold: 38-39).

(d) Vasumitra: the difference between the times is a difference of position (avasthā-anyathātva), according to activity (kāritra)

Vasumitra’s argument is considered to be the most promising by Vasubandhu. Vasumitra argues that the difference between the times is the difference in position or state of a dharma. We may imagine a chess piece on a board—the piece remains the same, but its position on the board may alter. This, for Vasumitra, is comparable to the dharma passing through the three temporal stages—it maintains its intrinsic nature permanently, and yet it changes its position from future, to present, to past. But then, how are these positions distinguished from one another? The response provides a great conceptual innovation: it is the exercise of a dharma’s activity (kāritra) that determines its position in the temporal order. Though a dharma always retains an intrinsic nature, the manifestation of that nature, its activity, occurs dependent on certain causes and conditions. So, whilst a dharma with the intrinsic nature of heat always exists with that nature, it is only when a match is struck that some of the heat dharmas which partially make up the match (since dharmas are atomic, there will be many different kinds in a single matchstick) will manifest that quality. A dharma that is yet to manifest its activity is a future dharma, one that is currently exercising its activity is a present dharma, and one that has already exercised its activity is a past dharma. In this way, Vasumitra maintains the permanent nature of dharmas whilst offering an account of temporal difference that does not appear to conflict with this permanent nature. This argument proved appealing, and Vasubandhu states that it is the most convincing of the four arguments put forward, although he went on to criticise it.

d. Causation Between Dharmas (The hetu-pratyaya Model)

Having developed an account of reality based on a reductive methodology and concluding that only the atomic tri-temporally existing dharmas are ultimately real, the Sarvāstivāda sought to detail how these dharmas came to arise and cease in our phenomenal experience. In other words, they sought to understand the conditions under which a dharma carried out its activity (kāritra). One reason for this is that the Sarvāstivāda believed causal efficacy, as well as irreducibility, to be a mark of an ultimate existent. Objects built from dharmas appeared to have causal efficacy, but in reality, it was the dharmas that did the work. The reason for this requirement for causal efficacy is clear, if the Sarvāstivāda project is an account of reality which is supposed to provide guidance on how to reach Nirvana, then it ought to explain how to cause that outcome (and how to stop that which obstructs this outcome). In providing this account, the Sarvāstivāda, in their characteristic style, developed a taxonomy of causes (hetu) and conditions (pratyaya) for dharmas. So, for a dharma to be recognised, and therefore acknowledged to be ultimately real, it must fit into at least one of these causal categories.

The distinction between a “cause” (hetu) and a “condition” (pratyaya) is partially chronological. An explicit reference to the fourfold division of conditions is clearly found in the discourses of the Buddha. The four consist of: (i) the causal condition (hetu-pratyaya), (ii) the equal-immediate condition (samanantara-pratyaya), (iii) the object-condition (ālambana-pratyaya), and (iv) the dominant condition (adhipati-pratyaya). The Sarvāstivāda went on to develop another model—the sixfold division into causes (hetu). The six causes are: (a) homogenous cause (sabhāga-hetu), (b) universal cause (sarvatraga-hetu), (c) resulting cause (vipāka-hetu), (d) co-existing cause (sahabhū-hetu), (e) conjoined cause (saṃprayuktaka-hetu), and (f) efficient cause (kāraṇa-hetu). This framework of causes overlaps with the fourfold division of conditions. Five of the causes (a-e) fall under the category of causal condition (hetu-pratyaya). The sixth cause (f) is correlated to the fourth condition. The conceptual distinction between the two taxonomies appears to be that the condition (pratyaya) is a more generic and less specific account of cause, whereas the cause (hetu) is a more fine-grained account, although this is by no means a strictly maintained difference. In an oft-cited example, the seed is the cause of the plant, but the soil, water, temperature, and so on, are the conditions. The Sarvāstivāda account, therefore, offers a picture of complex collections of permanently existing independent dharmas continuously interacting with one another, leading to our phenomenal experience of a dynamic and fluctuating reality.

In what follows, the main headings are the divisions of conditions (pratyaya), with subheadings detailing the division of causes (hetu) where appropriate.

(i) the causal condition (hetu-pratyaya)

In the Abhidharmakośa (2.61), Vasubandhu simply states that the causal condition is equivalent to five of the six causes. These causes are as follows:

(a) homogenous cause (sabhāga-hetu)

A homogenous cause is one in which the effect is of the same kind as the cause, with the common example used by Sarvāstivāda philosophers in explaining this cause often having a moral tone. For example, a morally good dharma will be the cause of another morally good dharma. In less moral terms, we might think that a given colour dharma will, in the absence of any other interfering dharma, act as a homogenous cause for the immediately following activity of another colour dharma of the same kind. As such, the homogenous cause applies to both mental and material dharmas. It helps to explain the phenomenal experience of continuity in a world of interacting dharmas.

(b) universal cause (sarvatraga-hetu)

A dharma is a universal cause if it falls under the category of “universal defilement” (see section 4). These are essentially dharmas that lead to ignorance and suffering, and can be obstructed or abandoned through knowledge of the Four Noble Truths and following the Buddhist path. They are similar to the previously described homogenous cause in that they also produce an effect in kind, except that, unlike the homogenous cause, the kind under consideration is broader. For example, the homogenous cause can only make a dharma of the same kind, so a material colour dharma, when conceived as a homogenous cause, can only produce the same kind of material colour dharma as an effect. But the defilement dharma of “delusion” (moha: the dharma that is a mental occurrence of delusion) has the universal cause of producing other defilement dharmas that may extend beyond its own kind, such as producing the defiled dharmas of “idleness” (kauśīdya) or “non-diligence” (pramāda), rather than simply another “delusion” dharma.

(c) resulting cause (vipāka-hetu)

This is the Sarvāstivāda method of incorporating the law of karmic consequences into its account of dharmas. Dharmas of all categories associated with the self (meaning the five skandhas) may be coloured with a moral quality, for example, a mental dharma of anger may contaminate the other dharmas within that matrix, and it will act as the resulting cause of future dharmas that are the karmic results of this anger. Note the importance of this cause in the Sarvāstivāda argument for dharmas existing at all times—it is because a dharma must act as a resulting cause to a karmic consequence that it is held to still exist even when its activity (the manifestation of its intrinsic nature) has ceased.

(d) co-existing cause (sahabhū-hetu)

It often appears that certain things are mutual causes. For example, when two playing cards lean against each other when a person begins to build a house of cards, it seems as though each card is the cause of the other remaining upright. Philosophers are cautious in accepting such scenarios as examples of causation, given that causation is characterised as an asymmetrical relationship between cause and effect. The Sarvāstivāda allowed for mutual causation in the form of their co-existing cause (sahabhū-hetu). Vasubandhu describes this causal category as “dharmas that are causes one of the other” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 257) and explains it as “in the same way that three staffs stand up supported one on the other” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 261). The reason for this is that the Sarvāstivāda took dharmas in the category of thought and the separate category of concomitant mental states to be mutual causes—when the thought manifests its activity, then so do the concomitant mental states. But it is also seen that when the associated mental states manifest their activity, then so does the mind (see section 3 for an explanation of these two categories). The later Sarvāstivāda philosopher Saṃghabhadra adds another explanation for this causal category—sometimes entities seem to have multiple causes that are all simultaneously required for the effect to take place (Dhammajoti: 175). When this occurs, they are said to be co-existent causes of the effect. This causal category is of particular importance to the Sarvāstivāda and their argument for the tri-temporal existence of dharmas, given their reliance on the Buddha’s claim that cognition arises with the sense-faculty and sense-object. The sense-faculty, sense-object, and cognition are therefore co-existing causes.

(e) conjoined cause (saṃprayuktaka-hetu)

The conjoined cause is a subset of the co-existing cause. It refers to dharmas of the thought (citta) category and mental concomitant (caitta) category, which share the same object. The Mahāvibhāṣā explains that these dharmas are weak in isolation and are only able to exercise their activity when together (Dhammajoti: 175-176). For example, a cognition of an object cannot take place with only one dharma of the thought or mental concomitant categories. Instead, it requires a number of different kinds of dharmas of both categories (as well as the dharmas that make up the object of cognition). The difference between the conjoined cause and the previous category of co-existing cause is that the conjoined causes always occur together, whereas co-existing causes bring about the same results. For the Sarvāstivāda, all conjoined causes are also co-existing causes, but not all co-existing causes are conjoined causes.

(ii) the equal-immediate condition (samanantara-pratyaya)

This is the characteristic of thought (citta) and mental concomitant (caitta) dharmas to “make way” for subsequent dharmas of the same kind (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 297-302; Dhammajoti: 196-198). In a particular collection of dharmas that make up one’s mental experience, the Sarvāstivāda hold that no two dharmas of the same specific type can occur together (for example, you cannot have two separate instances of anger occurring together). So, the equal-immediate condition is the tendency of a dharma to cease and give space to another dharma of the same kind (thus being “equal”) to arise without another dharma intervening in between (thus being “immediate”).

(iii) the object-condition (ālambana-pratyaya)

As seen in the arguments for the tri-temporal existence of dharmas, the Sarvāstivāda held that all objects of cognition are reducible to ultimately real dharmas. The object-condition is simply this claim—that all dharmas may act as objects for cognition. (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 302; Dhammajoti: 198-199). An interesting consequence of this view is that cognition cannot have an unreal object. This led the Sarvāstivāda to eventually distinguish between the “content” (ākāra) of a cognition and the real “object” (viṣaya) that causes the cognition, explaining a mistaken cognition as being one where the perceiver takes the illusory content to be the real object (Cox 1988).

(iv) the dominant condition (adhipati-pratyaya)

As Vasubandhu states, the “cause termed kāraṇa [efficient cause] is called adhipati, predominant” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 303). This condition is therefore equivalent to the causal category called “efficient cause.”

(f) the efficient cause (kāraṇa-hetu)

This category applies to all dharmas in relation to all other conditioned dharmas, and consists of the fact that, as Vasubandhu explains, “no dharma constitutes an obstacle to the arising of dharmas susceptible of arising” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 255). This category allows the Sarvāstivāda to grant a causal role to dharmas that would otherwise seem to lack one, and therefore lack reality, such as future dharmas. By not acting as an obstacle to the arising of dharmas, future dharmas are an efficient cause and therefore real.

The exhaustive and confusing treatment of causation is the result of the Sarvāstivāda desire to provide a comprehensive, systematic account of the Buddha’s teaching. As the teachings found in the discourses are so disparate, and the conservative nature of the religious tradition sought to hold on to as much as possible, many seemingly ad-hoc solutions were developed to maintain consistency and respond to critics. A similar approach can be found in the five-fold division of the 75 dharmas recognised by the Sarvāstivāda school.

3. The Ontology of the Sarvāstivāda (The Categorisation of Dharmas)

The Sarvāstivāda argue that reality consists of many individual dharmas interacting, manifesting their activity, then lying dormant again. This account of the general nature of dharmas and their causal relations is explained by the Sarvāstivāda’s metaphysics, as discussed in the previous section. But the Sarvāstivāda school also sought to list and categorise the various kinds of dharmas. It is this categorisation that forms the school’s ontology. Though there were many dharmas, the Sarvāstivāda believed they could be categorised into 75 types (even these types could have further divisions, but it is the grouping of 75 types that is taken to be the most useful reduction). These types could then be further grouped into five separate categories, and this became the highly influential five-fold division of dharmas, as can be seen by the importance of the categories “Thought” and “Mental Concomitants” in some of the Sarvāstivāda accounts of causation. The five-fold division was adopted by many Buddhists, including opponents of the Sarvāstivāda. Within these five-fold are further separate groupings of dharmas, which become important in outlining the Buddhist path to liberation. The following is a useful reference, adapted from a very helpful list of the 75 dharmas provided by Dhammajoti (41-42):

It is interesting to note that only one category consists of matter, and this contains 11 types of dharmas. Two categories relate to human mental experience, and these make up the majority of dharma types (47 in total). This highlights the fact that behind the exhaustive analytic reduction of the Sarvāstivāda lies the Buddhist emphasis on liberation from the phenomenal experience of the world and the condition of suffering.

Whilst it is outside the scope of this entry to discuss every dharma type, the following sections will discuss the general features of each of the five-fold categories, touching upon some unusual dharma types when appropriate.

a. Matter (rūpa)

The category of matter (rūpa) contains the sense-faculties and sense-objects of cognition. Each sense-faculty is distinct and has its own sphere of operation, so the visual sense-faculty cannot combine with the auditory sense-object to produce a cognition, just as the eyes cannot see music, though they may see the physical writing of musical notation. The division of ten types of sense-faculty and sense-object dharmas resembles the Buddha’s teaching of the sensory bases (āyatana) found in his discourses.

Vasubandhu provides two definitions for the classification of dharmas as matter: (i) that they are breakable, meaning that they are liable to transformation, and (ii) that they are resistant, so that a particular rūpa dharma acts as an obstacle to another rūpa dharma taking its space (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 70). The latter definition is the one emphasised by most Sarvāstivāda philosophers, and accords well with an intuitive understanding of matter.

The unusual dharma in this category is that of invisible matter (avijñapti). There was much dispute over the precise nature of this type (see Dhammajoti: 425-427), but its function was to provide scope for karmic consequences within the rūpa division of dharmas, given that the Sarvāstivāda account of resulting cause (vipāka-hetu) applies to all five divisions of dharmas. The avijñapti dharma is, therefore, the invisible dharma that is activated following an intention to act. Not all intentions produce actions—a person may intend to cause harm or do good, and yet the opportunity to do these may not be available. A person can also be physically restrained from acting on a particular intention (for example, if one is held back from striking someone). As karmic consequences are thought to apply to intentions, the avijñapti dharma is one that can be produced in the absence of physical action, and will eventually produce a dharma that is the karmic consequence of the intention.

Its subsumption under a non-mental category is thought to maintain its existence outside of the fluctuations of mental states (Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam 1.11). For example, it continues to be active even when one is in a deep and dreamless slumber, and therefore lacks mental activity. At root, the avijñapti dharma acts as a guarantee of karmic consequences, carrying the seeds for its later fruition. The attempt to justify the inclusion of avijñapti in the matter category (rūpa) is, however, unconvincing, since the Sarvāstivāda accept that it is not resistant and so it does not meet the definition of a rūpa dharma. Vasubandhu explains the Sarvāstivāda position as holding that, since the avijñapti is dependent on matter (and thought) for exercising its activity, then it should also be considered under the matter category, in the way a shadow is part of a tree from being dependent on a tree (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 71-72). Vasubandhu himself noted that this seems contrary to the Sarvāstivāda reductionist methodology.

b. Thought (citta)

Thought contains a single dharma type, though the terms “mind” (manas) and “cognition” (vijñāna) are said to name the same type, only highlighting its different aspects (Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam 2.34). Recalling the Buddha’s account where a sense-faculty and sense-object arise with the relevant sense-consciousness, Vasubandhu explains the character of this consciousness as “the impression relative to each object” and the “raw grasping of each object” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 74). Thought is the raw part of cognition that is uncoloured by other mental factors (which fall under the category of “mental concomitants”). It is only through being associated with the mental concomitants that a cognition has content in the form of what we call propositional knowledge. The thought dharma grasps a blue dharma, but it is the thought dharma occurring with certain mental concomitant dharmas that generates the experience “this is blue.” It is important to note that the Sarvāstivāda held that thought dharmas always occur with mental concomitant dharmas (and vice-versa), and not in isolation (Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam 2.23). Due to this, the thought dharmas and mental concomitant dharmas are the paradigm example of mutually caused dharmas, defined as co-existing causes (sahabhū-hetu) and conjoined causes (saṃprayuktaka-hetu) in the Sarvāstivāda causal hetu-pratyaya framework. It is for this reason that the categories of “thought” (citta) and “mental concomitants” (caitta) are often discussed together by Buddhist philosophers as citta-caitta or citta-caitasika dharmas.

c. Mental Concomitants (caitta/caitasika)

The category of mental concomitants contains 46 of the 75 dharma types and highlights the fact that the Sarvāstivāda were primarily concerned with understanding the phenomenology of human experience as it relates to ending existential suffering. They occur together with thought dharmas (citta) to produce contentful cognition, and the presence of particular mental concomitants will indicate the quality of the thought dharma occurring with them. This is because most of the mental concomitant dharmas are considered to have a moral value, the importance of which will become clear in section 4 of this article. Note that multiple types of mental concomitant dharmas occur in the same instance of cognition, alongside one another. The mental concomitants are further grouped into six kinds: (i) universal dharmas, (ii) skilful universal dharmas, (iii) unskilful universal dharmas, (iv) universal defilement dharmas, (v) non-universal defilement dharmas, and (vi) indeterminate dharmas.

Universal dharmas (mahābhūmika dharmas) are of 10 types, and are called so because they occur in all minds (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 189), where “mind” means the collection of causally interacting dharmas that constitute our everyday understanding of the mind of an individual person. A number of these universal dharmas help explain contentful cognition, such as conceptual perception (saṃjñā), which grasps the mark of an object, providing the foundation on which to apply concepts and linguistic labels. For example, it discerns the “blueness” of an object, allowing one to apply the label “blue.” Other dharmas of this type account for the phenomenological colour of mental experiences, such as “feeling” dharmas (vedanā), which explain the attitude of desire or aversion to a perceived object. Finally, a number of universal dharma types, such as volition (cetanā) and inclination (chanda), capture the Sarvāstivāda emphasis on causal dependence for dharma activity and the importance of intention in the analysis of karmic consequences.

There are further dharmas classed as “skilful” (kuśala) or “unskilful” (akuśala), and are called “universal” because the skilful ones are found in all skilful minds, and the unskilful are found in all unskilful minds (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 190, 195). Once again, “mind” here means the causally interacting dharmas that give rise to our everyday understanding of the mind of a person. A dharma is considered skilful when it helps produce further dharma activity that will end in liberation, and it is considered unskilful when it produces further dharmas that keep one in the realm of existential suffering. The terms are therefore imbued with moral significance, as is apparent from dharma types such as “faith” (śraddhā), “calm” (praśrabdhi), and “non-violence” (avihiṃsā) being classed as skilful, whilst “non-modesty” (āhrīkya) and “shamelessness” (anapatrāpya) are classed as unskilful. There are 10 universal skilful dharma types, and only two universal unskilful dharma types, as mentioned previously.

The concept of defilement (kleśa) is of significant importance to the Sarvāstivāda account of the Buddhist path to liberation. A defilement dharma is held to infect the collection of other dharmas that make up a person, and so to “defile” the collection, meaning it causally interacts with other morally bad dharmas, causing them to manifest their activities, keeping the collection (person) within the realm of existential suffering. The goal of Buddhist practice is to produce the cessation of these defilement dharmas. The universal defilement dharmas (kleśa-mahābhūmika dharma) are those that occur in every defiled mind, such as error (moha) and idleness (kauśīdya) (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 193), and the non-universal defilement dharmas (parīttakleśa-bhūmika dharma) are those that only occur in some defiled minds, and include dharmas such as anger (krodha) and pride (mada) (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 196). There are six types of universal defilement dharmas, and 10 types of non-universal defilement dharmas.

Finally, there are eight indeterminate dharmas of the mental concomitants category. As the name implies, the moral status of these dharmas is not determined without reference to context. For example, the “sleep” (middha) dharma is unskilful when indulged in unnecessarily, but skilful when one requires refreshment to continue engaging in morally good thought and actions (Dhammajoti: 252).

The detailed analysis contained in this category demonstrates the Sarvāstivāda focus on explaining phenomenal experience. But alongside this, the school maintained a commitment to the objective reality of dharmas, holding them to not depend upon our subjective experiences. The introduction of the categories of “conditioned dharmas separate from thought” (citta-viprayukta-saṃskāra) and unconditioned dharmas (asaṃskṛta) reflects this tendency in the Sarvāstivāda.

d. Conditioned Dharmas Separate from Thought (citta-viprayukta-saṃskāra)

As the Sarvāstivāda held that only dharmas are ultimately existent, then, alongside including the elements of phenomenal experience into their description, they also needed to account for certain metaphysical principles that were not reductions of phenomenal experience. This led to the two final categories of the five-fold division of dharmas, one of which is the category of “conditioned dharmas separate from thought” (citta-viprayukta-saṃskāra).

There are 14 dharma types included in this category. By “conditioned” (saṃskāra) is meant that these dharmas manifest their activity in dependence upon causes and conditions, like all dharmas of the previous categories discussed. The specification that they are “separate from thought” is used to indicate that these dharmas are non-material, and therefore do not fall under the “matter” (rūpa) category, and non-mental, therefore falling outside of the “thought” (citta) and “mental concomitant” (caitta/caitasika) categories (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 206). In a sense, they are metaphysical principles conceived as ontologically real constituents of reality. In line with the Sarvāstivāda commitment to the objectivity of their description of reality, these principles are ultimately real entities, although neither material nor mental. Since they resemble metaphysical principles, they can affect both material and mental dharmas. Dhammajoti notes that in “some cases at least, they may be considered as laws of nature” (323). In other cases, they are simply the Sarvāstivāda attempt to fit explanations used by the Buddha in his discourses into the reductive dharma model of reality.

The motivation from a metaphysical principle can be seen in the inclusion of a “resemblance” (sabhāgatā) type of dharma, which causes the perception of resemblance between different entities. Vasubandhu points out the Sarvāstivāda reasoning for the inclusion of this. He notes that numerically distinct entities have a likeness, as indicated by our general concepts and expressions (such as using the term “tree” to refer to numerically distinct individual trees). Since there must be something that is the cause of their likeness to one another, and since only dharmas can have causal efficacy, there must be a dharma that fulfils this function. This is the “resemblance” dharma (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 220).

This category also includes the “acquisition” (prāpti) and “non-acquisition” (aprāpti) dharma types. Almost all Buddhists hold that the self is an illusion. For the Sarvāstivāda, reality consists of complex interactions between different dharmas, and these interaction gives rise to our phenomenal experience of the world. But since there is no self, this seems to give up the value and moral impetus for individual agency. If there is no self, who is to pursue the Buddhist path? There is also the question of karmic consequences—if there is no self, what stops the bad actions of one “person” from leading to bad consequences for an unrelated second “person”? There is also a need to explain the phenomenal experience of continuity. The world is not an incoherent assemblage of phenomenal experience; it seems to follow a logical pattern. To address these concerns, the Sarvāstivāda claimed that what was mistaken to be the self was in fact a “personal series” or “stream” (santati/santāna) of dharmas. And it is the “acquisition” (prāpti) dharmas that hold together the series (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 207). When a particular dharma arises based on causes and conditions, an “acquisition” dharma may also arise to connect it with the personal series. This can be something as simple as maintaining the material continuity of what is taken to be a person, to the acquisition of mental defilements which obstruct a person from attaining liberation. The “non-acquisition” (aprāpti) dharmas act in the opposite fashion. They may be produced by skilful dharmas in a given stream and disconnect certain defilement dharmas from that stream.

In order to support the Buddha’s claim that reality is characterised by impermanence, meaning that all entities arise and cease, the Sarvāstivāda also included four types of dharma in this category that are often known collectively as “characteristics of the conditioned” (saṃskṛta-lakṣaṇa). In this way, the Sarvāstivāda hope to show that the Buddha’s remarks were an accurate description of ultimate reality. The four characteristics of the conditioned are “origination” (jāti-lakṣaṇa), “duration” (sthiti-lakṣaṇa), “deterioration” (jarā-lakṣaṇa), and “destruction” (anityatā-lakṣaṇa) (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 238). The “origination” dharma acts, along with other causes and conditions, on a dharma that has not yet manifested its activity. Once this future dharma arises, the “duration” dharma acts as a cause for it to manifest its activity and produce other dharmas for a period of time, until the “deterioration” dharma weakens this production, and finally, the “destruction” dharma causes the activity to cease completely.

The category of “conditioned dharmas separate from thought” (citta-viprayukta-saṃskāra) provides one of the more philosophically rich categories of dharmas, and highlights some of the key metaphysical concerns and innovations of the Sarvāstivāda.

e. Unconditioned Dharmas (asaṃskṛta)

The category of unconditioned dharmas is the most contentious and much criticised by the opponents of the Sarvāstivāda. As the name implies, the dharmas of this category are unconditioned, meaning they are neither causes nor effects. This seems to fly in the face of the Buddhist commitment to impermanence, and yet the Sarvāstivāda maintained the ultimate existence of three kinds of unconditioned dharmas: (i) space, (ii) cessation with knowledge, and (iii) cessation without knowledge.

Unconditioned space is defined by Vasubandhu as “not hindering matter,” since matter occurs in space, and also as “not being hindered by matter,” because matter dharmas do not displace the unconditioned space dharma (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 59). The Sarvāstivāda teacher Vasumitra attempted to justify its ultimate existence by arguing that this could be inferred from our direct perceptions (Dhammajoti 555). For example, space has the nature of accommodating other dharmas. It is also due to this accommodation that we can specify the location of any entity. In the absence of an ultimately real space, this would not be possible. Similarly, since space is defined as that which does not hinder, then in the absence of its real existence, reality should be characterised as being hindered everywhere, preventing anything from arising. Space acts as the condition for the possibility of the arising and ceasing of dharmas due to its nature of non-hinderance. Such arguments show that the Sarvāstivāda were committed to an absolute conception of space in their dharma theory—the unconditioned space dharmas are like the background upon which other dharmas act, and it is for this reason that they are held to be beyond the requirement for causes and conditions.

The “cessation with knowledge” (pratisaṃkhyā-nirodha) is connected to the Sarvāstivāda formulation of Nirvana. Recalling that the Buddhist goal is the ending of existential suffering from the cycle of rebirths, the Sarvāstivāda metaphysical picture conceives of this as the cessation of future dharmas occurring in a given stream, such that the entire stream ceases at death. Certain dharmas, known as “defilements,” can negatively affect the stream, preventing this liberation from occurring by producing more dharmas. When one acquires knowledge of the truth of Buddhist teaching and learns to discern reality correctly, one’s stream disconnects from the defilement dharmas and acquires the “cessation with knowledge” dharma, which prevents these defilements from attaching to the stream again (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 59). It should be noted that whilst this kind of dharma mirrors the Buddha’s account of Nirvana, there is a separate “cessation with knowledge” dharma for each impure dharma. These dharmas are considered unconditioned since they do not exercise any activity; it is their possession in a stream which explains the ability to maintain disconnection from a specific defilement dharma.

The “cessation without knowledge” (apratisaṃkhyā-nirodha) dharmas are those that also disconnect certain dharmas from one’s stream, but not due to any knowledge of the truths of the Buddha’s teachings. This makes sense of the limited sphere of our attention, and the fact that when one is focused on perceiving a particular object, this excludes the ability to perceive other objects (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 60). For example, when focusing on reading, one may not hear one’s name being called. That sound dharma then moves from the present to the past. The stream is therefore disconnected from any mental dharmas that may have arisen from the audible perception of that sound dharma, such as desire or jealousy (say, if one is romantically attracted to the person calling one’s name). As the example highlights, the cessation involved in these dharmas is accidental to the intention of the person.

4. Dharma Theory as a Means to Liberation

A focus on the system building and taxonomy of the Sarvāstivāda, whilst necessary, can sometimes distract from the school’s overriding concern—providing an account of the Buddhist method for liberation. The whole Sarvāstivāda project is an attempt at developing this, and the dharma theory is the outcome. This section will explain how the metaphysical view and liberation aspirations of the Sarvāstivāda come together.

For Buddhists, existence in the cycle of rebirths is characterised by suffering (duḥkha). Given the law of karma, our existence when we are ignorant of the Buddhist path leads to actions that will generate karmic consequences. The need for the fruition of these consequences will ensure the prolongation of existence in the cycle of rebirth—one is reborn in order for the effect to take place. The cessation of this rebirth and suffering, which means liberation from existence, is Nirvana, and this acts as the goal of Buddhist practice.

For the Sarvāstivāda (and other Buddhist schools), what is taken to be a self is in fact a stream (santāna) of material and mental dharmas causally interacting and manifesting their nature. The activity of certain dharmas leads to the production of activity in other dharmas, which keeps the stream together across different lifetimes. Certain dharmas that attach to a stream act to continually produce further dharmas that maintain one within the cycle of rebirth. These are known as defilements (kleśa/anuśaya). They infect almost all other dharmas of a stream, causing their impurity. The defilement dharmas are often mental attitudes, and they fall under the “mental concomitant” category of the five-fold taxonomy (see section 3.c). They include ignorance (moha), idleness (kausīdya), and agitation (auddhatya).

It is, however, possible for a stream to abandon these defilement dharmas. By abandoning these, the stream removes the causal conditions that lead to certain actions, which keep one within the cycle of rebirths. But in order to be able to abandon these negative dharmas, the practitioner needs to understand the dharmas, know the natures of each, know which are defilements, and know the methods of abandoning them. The link between knowledge of dharmas and liberation is eloquently stated by Vasubandhu in Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam (1.2): “Apart from the discernment of dharmas, there is no means to extinguish the defilements, and it is by reason of the defilements that the world wanders in the ocean of existence” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 57).

The final abandonment of all defilements from a stream is gradual and takes many lifetimes. It involves strict adherence to monastic discipline, developing the values of the Noble Eightfold Path, meditation, and cultivating the practices of skilful dharmas.

5. Criticisms of the Sarvāstivāda

The Sarvāstivāda, in producing a comprehensive and systematic elaboration of Buddhist thought, enriched Indian philosophy with its development of a new conceptual vocabulary and metaphysical model. The school’s influence within Buddhist philosophy can be seen by the many criticisms these developments received from other Buddhist philosophers, and the exchanges between the schools led to a growing complexity and sophistication of philosophical argumentation. This section will note three lines of criticism against the Sarvāstivāda from three separate Buddhist schools.

a. Sautrāntika Criticism of Ontological Promiscuity and the Tri-Temporal Existence of Dharmas

The name of the Sautrāntika school derives from the word “sūtra,” and reflects their belief that the Sarvāstivāda had strayed too far from the words of the Buddha in its attempt to provide a metaphysical system for these teachings. Their criticism of the Sarvāstivāda is all the more interesting since the Sautrāntika agreed that most of our experience can be reduced to basic elements, and that only what is irreducible after such analysis is ultimately real. But they argued that the Sarvāstivāda were too promiscuous in their ontology—they included too many entities as ultimately real dharmas, when these entities could in fact be further reduced. For example, the Sarvāstivāda claim that there are two kinds of dharmas known as “absorption” (asaṃjñi-samāpatti and nirodha-samāpatti) that belong to the category of “conditioned dharmas separate from thought.” They are produced by meditative practice, and once a stream acquires either of these dharmas, the dharma manifests its activity of arresting the mind and mental concomitant dharmas of that stream. But Vasubandhu, writing as a Sautrāntika, sees no reason to include this phenomenon as an ultimately real dharma. He admits that a halting of the mind and mental states can occur, but he writes that what “is called “absorption” is simply the non-existence of the mind for a certain period of time” (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 232). It is an absence rather than a positive entity. The admission of a dharma to account for the phenomena is unnecessary, and so if the Sarvāstivāda were more rigorous in their reductive method, they would not include it (as well as many other supposed dharmas) as an ultimate constituent of reality.

The same attitude is held by the Sautrāntika in their criticisms of the Sarvāstivādin’s key doctrine—that dharmas exist in the past, present, and future. The Sarvāstivādin believed that there was a difference between the intrinsic nature of a dharma (svabhāva), which it retains eternally, and the manifestation—or activity (kāritra)—of this essence when certain causes and conditions are present. The idea of an intrinsic nature allowed the Sarvāstivādin to claim that dharmas existed in all times, and the concept of dharma “activity” allowed the Sarvāstivādin to explain the experience of temporal change. The Sautrāntika offer many responses, one of which argues against this distinction. As Vasubandhu explains, the Sarvāstivādin must either accept that the activity of a dharma is a separate thing from the dharma, or that it is not separate. If separate, then the activity itself must also be temporal, and exist first in the future, then in the present, and finally in the past. But in order to explain which of these stages it belongs to, the activity will also need a second activity, and this will require a further activity, leading to an infinite regress (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 811). Alternatively, if the activity is not considered separate from the dharma, and if a dharma always exists (as the Sarvāstivādin maintains), then it will always exercise its activity, and there would be no distinction between the time periods (Vasubandhu 1988-1990: 812).

The Sautrāntika approach to the Buddhist reductive project differs and argues that reality consists of momentarily existing and causally interacting basic elements, which they call svalakṣaṇa. These can arise and cease to exist, yet the Sautrāntika believe their model can adequately explain reality in a more parsimonious manner, and without, in their view, the heretical innovations of notions like intrinsic nature (svabhāva) and unconditioned dharmas (asaṃskṛta). The dispute between the Sautrāntika and Sarvāstivāda is captured in full detail by Vasubandhu in his Abhidharmakośabhāṣya, where the verses present the Sarvāstivāda view and the commentary often argues in favour of Sautrāntika criticisms, reflecting Vasubandhu’s own intellectual movement towards the latter school.

b. Madhyamaka Criticisms of Intrinsic Nature (svabhāva) as Incompatible with Dependent-Origination (pratītya-samutpāda)

The Madhyamaka school of Buddhist philosophy emerged within the broader Mahāyāna movement of Buddhism. This movement had a significant impact on the practice, spread, and intellectual development of Buddhism throughout the world. It was characterised by a commitment to the bodhisattva path, which required those on the threshold of liberation to willingly return to the cycle of rebirths and spread their knowledge until all beings were liberated, and by a growing collection of sūtras which emphasised the concept of “emptiness” (śūnyatā). The philosopher Nāgārjuna provided a philosophical analysis of this concept of emptiness, composing the “Root Verses of the Madhyamaka” (Mūlamadhyamakakārikā), which became the foundational text of the school.

Nāgārjuna presents emptiness as the absence of an intrinsic nature (svabhāva), and by characterising reality as empty, his work is seen as a direct criticism of the Sarvāstivāda. He argues that emptiness is equivalent to the Buddha’s teaching of dependent-origination (pratītya-samutpāda), which holds that everything depends upon causes and conditions for its existence. By introducing a notion of an eternal intrinsic nature, Nāgārjuna believes the Sarvāstivāda view leads to a conception of reality as static and unchanging. He writes that “if something existed by essential nature (prakṛti), then there would not be the nonexistence of such a thing” (Nāgārjuna 2013: 160). He also argues that if entities already exist with an intrinsic nature, then there would be no place for causation, for an “intrinsic nature that was produced by causes and conditions would be a product” (Nāgārjuna 2013: 154), meaning that it would be something dependent and not eternally existing, as the Sarvāstivādin claims. The major issue with such a view is that it would render the Buddhist path impossible, for without allowing for change, there is no way to alter one’s state of existential suffering into one of liberation.

Nāgārjuna’s style of argumentation is often puzzling and relies on paradoxes and reductio ad absurdum. This has led to many diverse interpretations of his philosophy, though there is little doubt that for him, the Sarvāstivāda notion of intrinsic nature (svabhāva) was incompatible with the soteriological goal of Buddhism and the Buddha’s teaching of dependent-origination. (For more details, see the article on Nāgārjuna.)

c. Yogacāra Criticism of Material Atomism

The Yogacāra school, also known as the Vijñaptimātratā, also emerged within the Mahāyāna movement. They argued for a form of idealism, claiming that the concept of “emptiness” is best understood as the absence of a duality between the perceived and the perceiver. Vasubandhu eventually came to adopt the Yogacāra view and offers an interesting criticism of the Sarvāstivāda project in his “Twenty Verses on the Proof of Consciousness Only” (Viṃśatikāvijñaptimātratāsiddhiḥ).

The Sarvāstivāda dharma ontology holds that material dharmas (rūpa) lead to our everyday phenomenal experience of macroscopic objects. These macroscopic objects do not truly exist; they are an illusion caused by the rūpa dharmas and our ignorance regarding the nature of reality. The Sarvāstivāda believe that the existence of rūpa dharmas is proven by our cognition of objects—the rūpa dharmas are the intentional object of cognition. But Vasubandhu argues that we do not perceive dharmas in our cognition, since they are imperceptible atoms, so this argument will not work (Vasubandhu 2018: 212). If the Sarvāstivāda argues that the object we perceive is a combination of rūpa dharmas, then Vasubandhu asks what is meant by combination. If the object of cognition is the physical touching of dharmas until they form a large perceptible object, Vasubandhu claims that “in the simultaneous conjunction with a group of six [other atoms], the atom [would have to] have six parts” (Vasubandhu 2018: 213). Since an atom is by definition something without parts, this would mean that the elements making the perceived object are themselves ultimately unreal by the Sarvāstivāda’s own standards.

Later, Sarvāstivādins, such as Saṃghabhadra, attempt to avoid such issues by drawing a distinction between the intentional object of a cognition and the object that is the real cause of this cognition (see Cox 1988).

6. Conclusion

The Sarvāstivāda school helped develop the Buddha’s teachings into a consciously philosophical project, attempting to provide a systematic account of the entire Buddhist outlook, from scriptural interpretation to meditative practice. Their metaphysical picture of permanently existing dharmas was extremely influential, and their associated conceptual innovations were hugely influential in Indian philosophy. A knowledge of their philosophy is therefore essential in understanding the details of philosophy in classical India, and especially important in understanding the later Buddhist schools that emerged as critics of the Sarvāstivāda.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Translations of Sanskrit Texts

• Nāgārjuna (2013). Nāgārjuna’s Middle Way: Mūlamadhyamakakārikā. Translated by Siderits, M. and Katsura, S. Somerville, MA, USA: Wisdom Publications. [originally written Mūlamadhyamakakārikā, c. 2nd century CE.]
• Vasubandhu (2018). Materials Toward the Study of Vasubandhu’s Viṁśikā (I): Sanskrit and Tibetan Critical Editions of the Verses and Autocommentary; An English Translation and Annotations. Translated by Silk, J.A. Cambridge, MA: Department of South Asian Studies, Harvard University. [originally written Viṃśatikāvijñaptimātratāsiddhiḥ and Viṃśatikāvṛtti, c. 4th-5th century CE.]
• Vasubandhu (1988-1990). Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam of Vasubandhu (4 volumes). Translated by Pruden, L.M. Berkeley, California: Asian Humanities Press. [originally written Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam, c. 4th-5th century CE]. (A highly influential text. The verses contain a comprehensive account of the Sarvāstivāda position, though the commentary that accompanies these verses is often critical of the Sarvāstivāda and appears to adopt a Sautrāntika perspective.)

b. Secondary Literature

• Bartley, C. (2015). Indian Philosophy: Hindu and Buddhist Ideas from Original Sources. London, United Kingdom: Bloomsbury Academic. (Ch. 3 offers a helpful introduction to the Abhidharma/ Sarvāstivāda philosophy.)
• Cox, C. (2004). “From Category to Ontology: The Changing Role of Dharma in Sarvāstivāda Abhidharma.” Journal of Indian Philosophy 32(5-6), 543-597. (A very detailed article on the philosophical motivations for certain conceptual developments in Sarvāstivāda thought.)
• Cox, C. (1988). “On the Possibility of a Nonexistent Object of Consciousness: Sarvāstivādin and Dārṣṭāntika Theories.” The Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 11(1), 31-87. (Includes an explanation and discussion of Saṃghabhadra’s defences of the Sarvāstivāda metaphysics).
• Dhammajoti, K.L. (2015). Sarvāstivāda Abhidharma (5th Revised Edition). Hong Kong: The Buddha-Dharma Centre of Hong Kong. (The most detailed and comprehensive account of Sarvāstivāda philosophy written in English, including many translations of passages from Sanskrit and Chinese texts.)
• Gold, J.C. (2014). Paving the Great Way: Vasubandhu’s Unifying Buddhist Philosophy. New York, USA: Columbia University Press. (The early chapters offer a good discussion of philosophical disputes involving the Sarvāstivāda, focusing on Vasubandhu’s Sautrāntika criticisms.)
• Potter, K. (ed.) (1996). Encyclopedia of Indian Philosophies Volume VII: Abhidharma Buddhism to 150 A.D. Delhi, India: Motilal Banarsidass Publishers Private Limited. (A very helpful introduction to Abhidharma thought, including the practical aspects of the spiritual path according to the Sarvāstivāda, such as meditation.)
• Siderits, M. (2007). Buddhism as Philosophy: An Introduction. United Kingdom: Ashgate Publishing Limited. (Ch. 6 provides a good introduction to Abhidharma and Sarvāstivāda arguments for their reductionist metaphysics.)
• Westerhoff, J. (2018). The Golden Age of Indian Buddhist Philosophy. Oxford, United Kingdom: Oxford University Press. (Ch. 1 gives a good introduction to Abhidharma thought, highlighting the aspects to which later Buddhist schools responded.)

Author Information

Zishan Khawaja
Email: zishan_k@hotmail.co.uk
United Kingdom