Emanuele Severino (1929-2020)

Severino’s system rejects both epistemic relativism and metaphysical transcendence, uniting logic and phenomenology within a single eternalist framework. Against the entire trajectory of Western thought, Severino promoted the Parmenidean claim that being is and cannot not be. Emphasizing the self-evidence of the appearing of becoming, the history of the West consists, according to Severino, in the conviction that every being can become—and therefore be—nothing. Since everything can become nothing, thus lacking any necessary or eternal being, every entity that appears within this historical horizon is implicitly conceived as having nothingness as its ultimate ontological ground. This, for Severino, is the very essence of nihilism. The negation of this impossibility (the negation that a being could be nothing) constitutes instead, says Severino, the most necessary and incontrovertible truth “that the negation of which is self-negating.” This incontrovertible truth finds one of its most fundamental determinations in the eternity of every being.

Over the course of six decades—confronting some of the main figures of the Western canon, from Parmenides, Plato and Aristotle to Hegel, Nietzsche and Heidegger—Severino developed a unique discourse concerning the relationship between nihilism and the tradition of the West, the incontrovertibility of the truth of being, the contradiction of becoming, the eternity of all beings. Severino referred to his work as “the language that testifies to destiny”; namely, a testimony to the eternal and necessary structure of the appearing and disappearing of the eternal beings—the “destiny of necessity.”

Life and Career
Philosophical Context and Intellectual Influences
The Eternity of Every Being
The Trajectory of the Main Works
Nihilism versus the Destiny of Truth
Technical Elements
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Career

Emanuele Severino was an Italian philosopher known for his extensive contributions to ontology and metaphysics, which center on a radical critique of Western philosophy’s conceptualization of being and time. He was born in 1929 in Brescia, Italy, and he died there in 2020. He studied at the University of Pavia, where, at only eighteen, he completed his thesis Heidegger e la metafisica (Heidegger and Metaphysics). In this early work, Severino already started challenging the prevailing interpretation of Heidegger as a thinker who had overcome metaphysics, arguing that he instead remained a radical metaphysician in an essential sense. He began his academic career at the Università Cattolica del Sacro Cuore in Milan, teaching first theoretical and then moral philosophy. In 1969, his philosophical theses were formally censored by the Congregatio pro Doctrina Fidei (Congregation for the Doctrine of the Faith) for their incompatibility with the Christian doctrine, particularly the belief in a creation ex nihilo and the existence of freedom. This episode—among the last inquisitorial procedures in modern intellectual history—led to his dismissal from the Catholic University and marked a decisive moment in his career. From 1970 to 2001, he held the Chair of Theoretical Philosophy at Ca’ Foscari University of Venice, where he shaped several generations of Italian thinkers. After retiring, he was appointed Professor Emeritus and later joined the Faculty of Philosophy at Vita-Salute San Raffaele University in Milan, where he taught “Fundamental Ontology” until 2020. He also lectured at the University of Padua, in the program “Death Studies and the End of Life.”

Over six decades, Severino authored nearly ninety books and a vast number of essays. His writings, now being systematically translated, include The Originary Structure, The Essence of Nihilism, Law and Chance, Beyond Language, War, and The Fundamental Tendency of Our Time. Despite his recognition in Italy as one of the few truly systematic thinkers since G. W. F. Hegel, his work remains relatively unknown internationally. This limited reception has been due to linguistic and cultural barriers, as well as the fact that Severino’s philosophy does not easily fit within either the analytic or continental traditions. He retained a complete intellectual independence from dominant schools such as phenomenology, Marxism, and the philosophy of language. His achievements were acknowledged with a membership in the “Accademia dei Lincei” and the conferral of Italy’s highest civil honor, the “Cavaliere di Gran Croce.”

2. Philosophical Context and Intellectual Influences

Severino’s philosophical formation took place within the tradition of Italian idealism and was decisively shaped by Gustavo Bontadini (1903–1990), under whom he studied at the Catholic University of Milan. Bontadini sought to revive classical metaphysics by reinterpreting it through the legacy of Italian idealism, especially the philosophy of Giovanni Gentile. Rejecting the traditional “naturalistic presupposition” that reality exists independently of thought, he argued that Gentile’s actualism had reopened the possibility of metaphysics after the critiques of modern philosophy. Rather than grounding the relationship between philosophy and Christianity primarily in medieval scholasticism, Bontadini emphasized the continuity between Christian thought and the Greek inquiry into the meaning of being.

This intellectual environment profoundly shaped Severino’s early philosophical development. From an early age he immersed himself in the works of Plato, Aristotle, Kant, Hegel, Schelling, Schopenhauer, and Leopardi, alongside the major representatives of twentieth-century Italian philosophy. During his university studies, Kant and Aristotle occupied a privileged place, while Bontadini’s lectures on The Critique of Pure Reason deepened his engagement with German idealism, particularly Gentile’s actualism. At the same time, Enzo Paci introduced him to phenomenology and to Plato’s Parmenides, opening a line of inquiry that would become decisive for the development of his own philosophy. This broad philosophical background led Severino to devote his doctoral dissertation to Martin Heidegger, whose work had only recently become accessible in Italy. Although his earliest interpretation regarded Heidegger as reopening the possibility of metaphysics, Severino would later argue that Heidegger, no less than the major figures of the Western tradition, ultimately remained within the horizon of nihilism.

Bontadini’s project also shaped Severino’s initial understanding of the relationship between philosophy and Christianity. Like his teacher, Severino initially believed that rigorous metaphysical inquiry could provide the deepest philosophical foundation for Christian faith. This conviction informed his earliest works, including La struttura originaria (1958), whose central thesis—that every being is eternal—was not yet regarded as incompatible with the Christian doctrine. The intellectual climate of the Catholic University encouraged this dialogue between Greek metaphysics and Christianity. Figures such as Agostino Gemelli and Francesco Olgiati promoted a renewed engagement with classical philosophy, and Severino’s earliest work was initially received with considerable appreciation within this milieu. Gemelli himself praised Severino’s interpretation of Parmenides and his ontological reading of the principle of non-contradiction as an important contribution to contemporary metaphysical inquiry.

During the early 1960s, however, Severino progressively abandoned the attempt to reconcile his philosophy with Christianity. Beginning with Studi di filosofia della prassi (1962) and culminating in the Postscript to Returning to Parmenides (1964), he concluded that the Christian doctrine of creation presupposes precisely what his philosophy denies: that beings come into existence from nothing and return to nothing. Since this assumption constitutes, in his view, the essential form of Western nihilism, Christianity itself came to appear as structurally incompatible with the originary structure of truth. This development also transformed Severino’s assessment of Italian idealism. Although he continued to regard Giovanni Gentile as one of the most significant philosophers of twentieth-century Italy and consistently admired the extraordinary conceptual rigor of his actualism, he argued that Gentile had carried the logic of becoming and self-production to its most coherent philosophical formulation. Precisely for this reason, Gentile represented not an alternative to Western nihilism but one of its highest expressions. Severino thus remained deeply indebted to both Bontadini and Gentile while simultaneously departing from their projects in a radical way.

The philosophical consequences of this development eventually led to a public controversy with the Catholic Church. In 1969 the Congregation for the Doctrine of Faith declared several of Severino’s central theses incompatible with the Catholic doctrine, leading to his departure from the Catholic University of Milan. Severino did not regard this controversy as an institutional conflict between philosophy and religion but as the inevitable consequence of a fundamental disagreement concerning the meaning of being and nothingness. Indeed, he welcomed the ecclesiastical examination of his writings because it made clear that his departure from the Catholic University resulted exclusively from the incompatibility between his philosophical conclusions and the Christian doctrine of creation. The investigation involved several leading Catholic philosophers and theologians, among them Cornelio Fabro, whose critique became one of the most influential Thomistic responses to Severino’s philosophy.

Severino nevertheless insisted that his critique was never directed against Christianity alone. In his view, Christian theology represents one of the highest historical expressions of the broader metaphysical tradition of the West, whose defining assumption is that beings emerge from and return to nothing. Modern atheism, no less than Christian theology, remains within the same horizon insofar as it accepts becoming as the passage of beings between being and nothing. His critique therefore extends to the whole history of Western metaphysics rather than to Christianity alone.

3. The Eternity of Every Being

At the core of Severino’s philosophy lies the affirmation of the eternity of every being, which he presents as a logical necessity rather than a theological claim. His entire corpus develops from the refutation of what he calls the unconscious thought of Western civilisation: the belief that becoming entails the coming-to-be and ceasing-to-be of beings. To think that something may begin or end to be means, according to Severino, to identify being with nothingness—an impossible contradiction. Every being, precisely because it is, cannot not be: therefore, it is eternal. This thesis is grounded in what Severino calls the “originary structure of truth”: the self-grounding opposition between being and nothing, or, more generally, between the positive and the negative. The negation of this opposition already presupposes it, since one can deny something only by distinguishing what is affirmed from what is denied. Thus, even the claim that being and nothing are indistinguishable implicitly relies on the very difference it attempts to abolish. Negating this opposition therefore entails a performative self-contradiction. The fundamental trait of Severino’s philosophy is precisely this elenctic character: truth is “the negation of which is self-negating”; every element of truth must be able to incontrovertibly establish its necessity (in such a way that every negation of that element would immediately refute itself).

From this ontological structure, Severino claims that there arises one of the most fundamental implications of the truth of being: if every being is eternal, then the appearing of every being, too—since it is not a nothingness but itself a certain being—must be eternal. Becoming does not therefore consist in a creation and an annihilation, but in the manifestation of appearing itself—in the eternal beings’ entering and leaving the circle of appearing (this present “stage” as part of which being appears). Birth and death, emergence and disappearance, only signify a transition in manifestation, not the origination or destruction of being. Whereas Aristotle states that “no becoming may be possible if there exists nothing eternal,” Severino asserts that “becoming is possible only if everything is eternal.”

The content of appearing does not and cannot include the appearing of the annihilation of (any) being. If the firewood turns to ash, there is no moment in which the content of appearing includes the impossible identity between the firewood and the ash; the firewood is no longer present—this, however, does not mean that the firewood has turned into nothing. The appearing of becoming does not testify to the annihilation of being: “the phaínesthai is silent about being that does not appear.” The only framework that does not contradict the “truth of being”—the incontrovertible and irrefutable self-being of every being: “that the negation of which is self-negating” – consist in the eternity of every being, whose entering and leaving the circle of appearing gives rise to the appearing of becoming. No being has ever been (or will ever be) annihilated; every being (including the being constituted by the appearing of another being) has always already been saved in and by its own eternity. “To return to Parmenides” therefore does not mean to repeat his lesson, but to go beyond it, affirming of each entity what the Eleatic master affirmed only of Being itself. The West’s millennial faith in becoming is thus revealed as the supreme folly – the belief that the eternal can become nothing – while the destiny of truth consists in the recognition that all beings are eternal and necessary.

4. The Trajectory of the Main Works

Every being necessarily is;E and the impossibility for every being not to be constitutes the very essence of eternity. This insight is developed in the fundamental work The Originary Structure (La struttura originaria – 1958), in which Severino formally defines the structure of knowledge as the anapodeictic ground—that which cannot be negated without presupposing it (the “incontrovertible” or the “irrefutable”: that the negation of which is self-negating). The originary structure expresses the incontrovertible opposition between the positive and the negative, and thus constitutes the logical site as part of which the necessity of eternity has always already appeared. In this work, Severino still speaks in the language of classical metaphysics, but he already moves beyond it by recognizing that experience never testifies to an increase or decrease in being, but only to the fact that something begins or ceases to appear. The becoming of things does not therefore mean their production or annihilation. Later reflections reveal that even The Originary Structure still lacked a full awareness of the nihilistic horizon it had already transcended; the persistence of the belief that becoming is the alternation of being and nothing continues to inhabit metaphysics precisely where it is most radically denied. In this work, freedom is indeed still conceived as the possibility of the contingency of being, in such a way that different choices could alter the course of what eternally appears.

The philosophical anti-nihilistic consolidation is announced with The Essence of Nihilism (Essenza del nichilismo – 1972; 2016). In the essays of this book, beginning with “Returning to Parmenides” (Ritornare a Parmenide) and its “Postscript” (Poscritto), Severino definitively breaks with the entirety of the Western tradition. Experience, he argues, never shows beings coming from or turning into nothingness; what appears is rather the manifestation of the eternal through a process of appearing and disappearing. This marks the mature formulation of his thesis: the temporal flux of the world is the self-showing (appearing) of what cannot not be. At this stage, Severino interprets the West’s faith in becoming as the unconscious belief that beings are nothing—a conviction that underlies every form of nihilism pervading metaphysics, theology, as well as the apparatus of science and technics. Freedom is thus redefined as the plurality of eternal possibilities, each necessary in its being. The question whether appearing unfolds necessarily or contingently finds its resolution in Destino della necessità (The Destiny of Necessity, 1980), in which Severino demonstrates that every appearing consists in the necessary manifestation of the eternity of beings and their necessary connections, and it is precisely within this necessity that every authentic freedom is revealed as impossible. The following sections will detail the content of Severino’s four theoretical works: The Originary Structure, The Essence of Nihilism, The Destiny of Necessity, The Glory.

a. The Originary Structure

The Originary Structure (1958) is the first and in many respects most notable of Severino’s works. It introduces and concretely presents the semantic core that unfolds throughout all of his subsequent writings. This semantic dimension forms the ground of everything that is and appears, insofar as everything that is and appears cannot be abstracted from its ground. Every negation of the originary connection between a content and its ground—that is, between every being and its being or truth—constitutes the concrete meaning of impossibility: the impossible identification between a being and its other. Every negation of the originary structure is concretely or incontrovertibly impossible because it must presuppose that which it attempts to negate, and in so doing, it must have always already failed to perform that negation. The originary structure is that semantic dimension the negation of which is immediately self-negating; everything that is and appears is and appears insofar as it is structured according to this originary meaning of being or truth. The truth of being is that the negation of which is self-negating. Equivalently, the concrete truth of being consists in that originary immediacy that has always already pre-empted every attempt at separating every being from its ground.

The Originary Structure thus marks the transition from metaphysical speculation to a discourse grounded in the necessity of what cannot consistently be negated. Knowledge, in this originary sense, is not the product of reasoning or empirical verification, but the immediate necessity in accordance with which being is, and its negation is immediately self-negating. The formal definition of the originary structure asserts that every act of knowing is already a manifestation of the truth that being cannot not be. This immediacy of being is the first and most fundamental value of knowledge. There is no epistemological gap between subject and object: appearing itself is the locus where being and thought coincide. The second value of the originary structure is the immediacy of identity or non-contradictoriness. Being is identical with itself, and its identity cannot be negated without presupposing it. Severino reformulates the Aristotelian principle of non-contradiction as an ontological truth rather than a merely logical one. Non-contradiction expresses the very structure of being, not a rule of discourse.

Severino shows that the ontological value of the principle of non-contradiction is here affirmed as the foundation of every possible meaning. There can be or appear no identity between being and nothing, which in turn implies that there can be no creation and no annihilation of being, no becoming: everything that is is eternally. This is the fundamental core that will be unfolded throughout his subsequent writings (first of all in order to account for the aporetic becoming of the appearing content).

Several other—more technical—axes guide the enquiry of The Originary Structure. These will be included in section 6.a.: Technical Elements: More about The Originary Structure.

b. The Essence of Nihilism

The Essence of Nihilism (1972) includes some of Severino’s most important essays, among which “Returning to Parmenides” and its “Postscript.” In the former essay, Severino re-affirms the eternity of every being that had already been anticipated in The Originary Structure and in the essay “Aristotle and Classical Metaphysics,” grounding it once again in that semantic core whose negation is self-negating: the truth of being, the self-being of every being. Separated (“isolated”) from its being—that is, from its incontrovertible self-identity and eternity—every being is a nothingness, and this is the essence of nihilism; the appearing of the history of the “folly,” the belief in the creation and annihilation of being, namely, in the existence of becoming. This “folly” consists in the belief that the totality of what appears, what Severino technically calls the earth (la terra), is isolated from its incontrovertible truth. Severino deliberately introduces the expression the earth rather than the more familiar “world” in order to distinguish this technical notion from the many philosophical meanings traditionally associated with the concept of “world.” The term designates the totality of beings as they ordinarily appear within human experience, prior to the recognition of their eternal nature. Once separated from the truth of being, the earth is understood as “nothing” (the positive meaning of “nothing” developed in The Originary Structure).

That semantic structure, the negation of which is self-negating—the originary structure—is further studied through an in-depth analysis of the élenchos, the logical refutation that discloses the error by exposing its self-contradiction. According to Severino, this ancient Greek concept expresses the originary movement of truth itself, negating that being is identical to itself (and thus eternal) means in fact to affirm it, for every negation presupposes the very distinction (between being and nothing) that it attempts to abolish. The élenchos thus reveals the fundamental opposition between the positive and the negative, grounding all discourse and experience in the incontrovertibility of being’s self-identity. Even Aristotle’s dialogical use of refutation, though it preserved the form of contradiction, still presupposed the possibility of non-being and therefore failed to grasp the full ontological value of the principle of non-contradiction. In Severino’s reconstruction, the élenchos is not merely a method of refutation, but the eternal structure of truth itself, for the necessity of appearing implies that affirming freedom or becoming as contingency is self-contradictory and always already superseded.

In the “Postscript” to “Returning to Parmenides,” Severino confronts a nihilistic residue that still inhabited The Originary Structure: not only is the becoming of beings incontrovertibly impossible, but it has also never been part of the content of appearing. The phaínesthai does not testify to the creation and annihilation of its content (the phaínesthai is silent about being that does not appear). Severino thus takes an essential step in the unfolding of his testimony of the originary truth of being; becoming, Severino asserts, consists in fact in the eternal beings’ entering and leaving the stage of appearing (the “circle of appearing”). As part of this unremitting sequence, no part of any being is either annihilated or created; every being is always saved in its eternity, as it enters the circle of appearing and leaves it unscathed. Each of the eternal configurations of being transitions into and out of the circle of appearing, but in so doing nothing is either lost or created. This is the only “veritable” configuration of the becoming of being that does not contradict its originary truth (the impossibility for being not to be).

The enquiry of The Essence of Nihilism concludes with one fundamental question: whether or not the sequence of the eternal beings—the concrete history of being—proceeds through an originary necessity or through an originary contingency. Here, the question of the contingency or necessity of history takes an essentially different form compared to the one of the history of nihilism: all the configurations of being are always already saved in their eternity; Severino is rather asking whether the question as to which eternals are going to enter the circle of appearing has always already been answered, or whether the eternals await their destiny to be determined.

c. The Destiny of Necessity

In The Destiny of Necessity (1980), Severino is for the first time able to answer the fundamental question of The Essence of Nihilism: the unfolding of the eternals follows a necessary course; every eternal being is always already eternally connected to the eternal beings that precede it and follow it (for these relations, too, are eternal, and so is every being’s “beginning to become,” which determines the necessity of the unfolding of the eternals); there is no isolated existence, for to appear is already to be bound within the infinite structure of necessary relations that constitute the eternal order. From this point onwards, Severino will refer to this necessary being and appearing of the eternals as “the destiny of necessity,” and to his own testimony of the truth of that incontrovertible site as “the language that testifies to destiny.”

This step marks the completion of the passage from the refutation of contingency to the affirmation of an entirely necessary infinite totality. Here lies the fundamental structure of being’s eternal appearing, as part of which every occurrence unfolds not by virtue of any chance, will or decision, but according to the incontrovertible law that being cannot not be. Thus, the temporal distinctions of past, present, and future arise from the finite perspective of the isolated earth; within the destiny of truth, all moments are eternally given. The necessity of the destiny of truth therefore affirms that the entire history of the world, including its temporal unfolding, is the eternal revelation of what has always already been and will forever be.

As in the case of The Essence of Nihilism, the enquiry of The Destiny of Necessity concludes with an essential question: having determined that the series of eternals follows a necessary course, is this sequence destined to manifest the end of the history of nihilism, or is the “isolated earth” bound to remain the alienated horizon of every appearing?

d. The Glory

In The Glory (2001), Severino addresses the question of whether the necessary sequence of eternals will bring about the end of the history of nihilism. The history of nihilism, Severino argues, is destined to come to an end. The sequence of eternals of the destiny of necessity includes the appearing of the eternals freed from their contrast with the isolation of the earth; the “Glory” consists in the concrete appearing of being in its non-alienated truth, that is, in the end of the “folly” of the belief in the impossible identity of being and nothing (whether this should take place as part of any becoming, creation and annihilation, or as part of any will, decision, signification or interpretation).

This fundamental step forward in Severino’s testimony takes place through the demonstration of the impossibility of the “unsurpassability” of a becoming determination or set of determinations. Only the determinations of the truth of being are incontrovertibly necessary; if any part of the arising content of appearing (in this case: those eternals that constitute the appearing of the history of nihilism) were to never leave the circle of appearing, they would begin to be necessary.That is, they would begin to be part of that always already appearing dimension that constitutes the truth of being (the “persyntax” of truth), thus contradicting their essential character of becoming (“hyposyntactic”) determinations. Therefore, every arising configuration of the eternals as part of the circle of appearing is destined to be surpassed—including that configuration that consists in the history of nihilism. This “logical sequence” (the series of implications that immediately follow from the incontrovertible originary structure of being) constitutes the necessity of the appearing of the Glory: the appearing of ever new dimensions of being, each freed from the isolation of the history of nihilism—which will have become a “perfectum,” its set of eternals having left the circle of appearing while still being saved in their eternity.

Thanks to this essential theorem, Severino will be able to establish further determinations of the appearing of being following the end of the history of nihilism; these further steps are included in the two major works Oltrepassare (2007) and La morte e la terra (2011). In The Glory, Severino puts this theorem to use in order to demonstrate the necessity (understood as an incontrovertible implication of that semantic core, the negation of which is self-negating) of the (infinite) multiplicity of the circles of appearing (for their finite number would instead constitute a dimension of being that must be surpassed). In this way, Severino is able to give a fundamentally different meaning to the demonstration of one of the fundamental questions of metaphysics: the existence of a multiplicity of instances of “consciousness.”

5. Nihilism versus the Destiny of Truth

a. The Fundamental Error of Western Thought

Severino identifies the entire trajectory of philosophy as unfolding within what he names the “folly,” consisting in the belief that being can become—and therefore be—nothing. Against this background, “returning to Parmenides” does not mean a repetition of the Eleatic master but a radical re-affirmation of the incontrovertible principle that being is and non-being is not. The Eleatic prohibition of contradiction is reinterpreted as an ontological law rather than a logical convention. Severino, however, insists that even the Parmenidean tradition, in its historical unfolding, became entangled in the very contradiction it had first uncovered. Melissus of Samos, by extending Parmenides’ monism, inaugurated the metaphysical conception of being as a single substance opposed to a multiplicity of appearances. This shift marks the beginning of classical metaphysics, as part of which being becomes an abstract unity detached from appearing. For Severino, this detachment is the first act of nihilism: the belief that appearing is not. The truth of being, therefore, must be rediscovered not in the abstraction of an immutable One, but in the appearing of the many eternal beings whose self-identity cannot be negated.

This clarification also reframes the Heideggerian “ontological difference.” Heidegger’s attempt to distinguish Being from beings, though intended as a retrieval of the forgotten question of ontology, retains the nihilistic premise that Being is something other than beings. Severino rejects this distinction as incoherent: there can be no “difference” between Being and beings, because difference itself is a being and, as such, eternal. In this way, what Heidegger calls ontological difference opens the door to the idea that Being could cease to exist or fall into nothingness—which is precisely the nihilism that truth must surpass. All the same, Severino argues that since the presence of a present being is not a nihil absolutum, when a present being is no longer present (or “unconcealed”), its very presence—something that is not nothing—must no longer be. It must have turned into nothing; there has to be a moment in which something-that-is is not.

From this vantage point, the entire history of Western thought unfolds as the history of nihilism: the conviction that beings are nothing. This conviction—implicit in metaphysics and in the modern apparatus of science and technology—constitutes what Severino calls the fundamental Western illusion. The freedom of being, which ancient metaphysics conceived as the capacity to become or cease to be, is instead the illusion that being can oscillate between existence and nothingness. The Western concept of the thing (res, ens) embodies this confusion. As the Greeks said, it is an epamphoterízein, “a hovering between being and non-being.” The culmination of this history occurs in the contemporary age, where the entification of nothingness—the transformation of nothing into some form of being—attains its extreme form in the age of technics, reaching its highest expression as the power of creation and destruction.

Truth, on the contrary, is not produced by any human or divine will, but is the self-appearing of being’s self-identity. Every attempt to relate truth to the dimension of the will (the Nietzschean “Wille zur Macht”) constitutes a form of violence, because it seeks to make what is not (the error) appear as what is (truth). Western thought, from Plato to Nietzsche and Heidegger, unfolds as the progressive intensification of this violence, essentializing the Path of Night and evolving as the history of epistemic metaphysics—from its rise to its fall (the so-called “death of God”)—culminating in the triumph of the apparatus of science and technics. Severino calls the totality of this necessity the “destiny of truth” (destino della verità).

Severino’s philosophy reinterprets the entire history of philosophy as the history of the destiny of truth. Philosophy, he argues, was born as the search for an incontrovertible truth, but gradually denied its own purpose by affirming the possibility of non-being. The so-called “death of God” and the rise of technics are not ruptures but necessary stages in this unfolding. In the pars destruens of his work, Severino exposes how metaphysics—from Plato and Aristotle through Christian theology—distorted the Parmenidean principle that being is, by introducing the notion that contingent beings oscillate between being and nothing. In the pars construens, developed in La Gloria (The Glory), Oltrepassare (Surpassing), and La morte e la terra (Death and the Earth), Severino argues that the nihilistic destiny of Western thought is itself destined to be overcome. From the standpoint of the destiny of truth, history is no longer understood as the production or disappearance of beings through time. Rather, it is the progressive appearing of eternally existing beings within the finite horizon of appearing. Human beings do not create history through their actions; instead, they participate in the historical unfolding of appearing, gradually coming to recognize the eternal nature of every being beyond the nihilistic perspective of the isolated earth.

One fundamental distinction articulates this framework: between the “persyntax” (persintassi), the eternal background of truth—the appearing of the originary structure itself—and the “hyposyntax” (iposintassi), the finite appearing of beings within history. Their necessary relation explains why historical phases—metaphysics as epistéme, the death of God, and the triumph of technics—form a coherent sequence within the destiny of truth and why each phase expresses a surpassable configuration of the error. Severino interprets the contemporary dominance of technics as the ultimate stage of nihilism: the belief that beings can be brought into being, transformed, or annihilated at will. Even this supreme form of violence, however, belongs to being itself and is destined to be surpassed by necessity. Severino calls Joy (Gioia) the appearing of the totality of beings. This Joy is not a psychological feeling, but the surpassing of all the contradictions of the finite, and thus also of the contradiction of nihilism. Within this horizon, theology too is transfigured. In the pars construens, developed in La Gloria (The Glory), Oltrepassare (Surpassing), and La morte e la terra (Death and the Earth), Severino argues that the nihilistic destiny of Western thought is itself destined to be overcome. The culmination of this overcoming is the disclosure of infinite totality of eternal beings. Although this conception recalls the classical philosophical identification of God with the totality of reality—as in Spinoza for example—it differs from it in a fundamental respect. In Spinoza, finite beings are modes of a single infinite substance, which alone is eternal and causa sui (whereas each finite being arises from nothing and returns to it); for Severino, by contrast, every being possesses an irreducible and eternal individuality. The appearing of the “Joy” (Gioia) is the complete manifestation of this eternal totality, in which every contradiction is resolved and the meaning of the divine is disclosed as the self-manifestation of the totality of eternal beings.

b. The Most Representative Figures of Nihilism

Severino identifies Giacomo Leopardi, Friedrich Nietzsche, and Giovanni Gentile as the three supreme figures of nihilism, each carrying the Western metaphysical tradition to its ultimate consequences. Leopardi, in his poetic and philosophical vision, unveils the essence of nihilism as the recognition of the nullity of all things. By affirming that everything arises from and returns to nothingness, he brings every immutable and eternal principle invoked by the metaphysical tradition to its end. In so doing, he expresses the most radical awareness of becoming as annihilation. The destruction of the Platonic “idea,” which once guaranteed eternal and universal order, coincides with the destruction of God as the pre-existing form of all things. According to Leopardi, if eternal beings existed, becoming would be impossible, since genuine becoming presupposes that things come into existence and pass away, whereas what is eternal can neither begin nor cease to be. Leopardi thus makes explicit what the Western tradition has generally taken for granted: that becoming necessarily entails the passage of beings between being and nothingness. The truth of becoming is therefore the truth of nothingness. Severino, however, argues that this position ultimately culminates in a contradiction, since it requires being to become non-being and non-being to become being, thereby violating the very principle of non-contradiction on which every assertion depends. Affirming that all things are nothing means affirming that what is not nothing is nothing—the very essence of nihilism. In this sense, Leopardi mirrors the error of the West: he affirms the identity of being and nothingness while still grounding his reasoning in their opposition. His thought thus both exposes and conceals the self-contradictory core of nihilism, which claims that “existing things are nothing”; he unknowingly undermines the very logical foundation that renders such a claim intelligible.

Nietzsche, in turn, brings nihilism to its full completion. For him, becoming is the only truth. Being is flux, and nothing remains identical to itself. The immutables posited by Platonic and Aristotelian metaphysics must therefore be abolished as the supreme negation of life. The will to create presupposes that nothing precedes creation, for if the divine “fullness” already contained all being, there would be nothing left to create. In L’anello del ritorno, Severino examines precisely this Nietzschean reasoning, which affirms an endless cycle of creation and destruction as the necessary consequence of the faith in the existence of becoming. Yet this “eternal return” conceals an impossibility: for a finite set of beings to return infinitely, it must from the very beginning be inscribed in the eternal background of appearing, thereby presupposing precisely what it denies—the immutable. The Nietzschean “ewige Wiederkehr des Gleichen” (the eternal recurrence of the same) thus turns against itself, revealing the absurdity of every attempt to make becoming absolute.

Gentile’s actualism, finally, transforms the destruction of the immutables into the most coherent form of nihilistic idealism. Rejecting every reality external to thought, Gentile asserts that reality only exists as the act of thinking in its self-development. History and thought are real only because they arise from nothingness; the “seriousness of history,” as Severino explains, depends on the fact that novelty emerges unpredictably from non-being. To affirm any immutable order would render becoming impossible and history illusory. Thus, according to Gentile, thought is absolute reality precisely because it is self-creating—but in affirming this, he implicitly accepts that being comes from nothing. The actualist dialectic, while eliminating external reality, sanctions the very contradiction of becoming as the ground of truth. Together, these three figures constitute the coherence of the folly of the West: Leopardi’s poetic nihilism, Nietzsche’s annihilation of the eternal, and Gentile’s idealist apotheosis of becoming all reveal the same faith in the annihilation of being. They are the culmination of the Western conviction that being is nothing.

c. Freedom as Alienated Content and the Nihilism of Faith

As part of the folly of the alienated content, the central theme lies in the contrast between the truth of being and the isolation of the earth. Every form of finite appearing, Severino argues, is marked by contradiction, for it discloses the Whole only in an abstract mode. This finitude generates the illusion of isolation: beings seem to exist independently of the truth of being. To “isolate” something means to assume that it can appear independently of the totality to which it belongs. On the contrary, no being can be separated from the eternal structure of being, for every being is incontrovertibly linked to the ever-present destiny of truth, which reveals the impossibility that anything could be unrelated to the totality of being. The dimension of appearing, however, forgets this relation, and takes the form of the “isolated earth”. Namely, of a finite world that mistakes its forgetting for independence. Freedom, conceived as the power to determine what is or is not, arises as part of this illusion. The “sacred” dimension of existence—the awareness of the eternal—is obscured, and it is alienated into a will to create and destroy being. In The Essence of Nihilism, Severino reinterprets the sacred as the manifest awareness that no being can ever fall into nothingness (as opposed to any divine command). As part of the nihilistic perspective, on the contrary, the sacred is inverted: it becomes identified with the freedom or power to annihilate—the supreme form of alienation. True freedom, instead, is the recognition of necessity: the acknowledgment that every being, every act, and every moment is eternal. The contingency of being and the contingency of appearing thus converge; what appears to be contingent only does so as part of the finite perspective from which eternity appears as change. The contrast between truth and isolation is not a dualism but a misunderstanding of appearing’s own limits. To rediscover the destiny of truth means to overcome the alienation of freedom and to recognize that all beings, including the isolated earth, eternally belong to the infinite dimension of appearing.

As part of his philosophical reconstruction, Severino confronts the theological dimension of Western thought, interpreting it as the most enduring expression of nihilism. Revisiting the Church’s historical response to his doctrine, he situates it within the broader conflict between metaphysical belief and the destiny of truth. The Church’s censorship of his philosophy in 1969, far from being a contingent episode, embodies for Severino the culmination of an age-old attempt to defend the notion that being can arise from nothing by virtue of a divine will. Theology, he argues, established the principle (faith) that God alone possesses true being, while every single being of the manifold only exist through a participation in the being of God, and may thus lapse into nothingness. This conviction reveals that the theological concept of creatio ex nihilo is not merely a dogma, but the ontological foundation of the West’s faith in becoming. The opposition between faith and reason, which the Church sought to reconcile, conceals a deeper identity, both of which rest upon the same assumption that being is mutable. Reason, as the exercise of finite thought, seeks certainty within contingency; faith, as trust in the transcendent, appeals to the same contingency as a sign of dependence on the divine will. For Severino, both positions are equally nihilistic because they constitute a negation of the incontrovertibility of being. The “response to the Church” thus becomes a philosophical response to the entire Western tradition: neither faith nor reason, as historically conceived, can grasp the necessity of being’s eternity.

In this perspective, doubt is revealed as the hidden foundation of faith. To believe, in the Christian meaning of the word, is to admit uncertainty—to rely on what cannot be demonstrated. Yet this very reliance presupposes that truth should not be immediately self-manifest, that being may not be, and that its confirmation should depend on an external act of will. Faith is therefore grounded in the same act of doubt that it seeks to overcome. It is the structure of nihilism itself: the will to hold as true that which can always be other than itself. The “root of the error,” Severino insists, lies precisely in the belief that something that is could cease to be. By denying the necessity of being, faith expresses the very dimension of violence—the violence that consists in the will for being to be other than itself.

The entire edifice of Western rationality thus rests on the unexamined assumption that being can be absent. Severino contrasts this with the “Orient,” which in certain traditions (such as Advaita Vedanta and Mahayana Buddhism) has at times glimpsed the unity and eternity of being. Yet even there, he cautions, the truth of being’s immutability is often conceived as an abstract totality or an ineffable void, rather than as the concrete appearing of every eternal being. While the Orient intuited the eternity of being and thus anticipated the negation of Western nihilism, it did not establish the incontrovertible logical foundation of this insight. The eternity of beings remained a religious or metaphysical intuition rather than a necessity that could not be refuted. As a result, the possibility that beings might nevertheless come into and pass out of existence was never definitively excluded. For Severino, this residual openness to non-being still belongs to the horizon of nihilism, since only the incontrovertible demonstration of the eternity of every being fully excludes the possibility of nothingness. Thus, both East and West remain bound to the same original conviction: that becoming is real and that things transition from non-being to being and vice-versa. As part of Severino’s account, the prehistory of the West is not an archaic episode but the ever-present ground of human alienation—the faith that being can be otherwise. Against this background, the destiny of truth emerges as the necessary overcoming of both faith and doubt, revealing that reason itself, once freed from its nihilistic premises, coincides with the manifest self-evidence of the eternity of being.

d. Language and the Interpreting Will

Consider the statement “the firewood appears.” Severino argues that in order for language to designate the firewood by means of the word “firewood,” the firewood itself must first be abstracted (isolated) from the totality in which it appears. Concurrently, the sign, the written or spoken mark that designates the firewood, must also have been isolated from the totality in which it appears so as to function as an ideal unity that designates the firewood. Only as such abstractions can the sign and the designated be linked to one another. At the same time, it is impossible for the relation through which the sign designates the thing to be incontrovertible; the sign would need to be separated from the thing (first impossibility), and it would then need to become other than itself in order to enter the very relation of signification with the thing (second impossibility). Only the concrete whole is incontrovertible: the abstract parts are nothing, and as such they cannot be; the faith in their existence is the conviction or persuasion that grounds the essence of the history of nihilism. One can only will that a sign should designate a thing; one can only believe what one wills and one can only will what one believes. But since what one wills is an abstraction (namely, the impossible), what ones wills is, in truth, nothingness itself. Severino writes:

Language is a way of making things become other: language is the will that certain events (certain things or—when there arises a reflection on the meaning of being—certain beings) be signs of certain meanings (that is, of certain other things or beings); and that certain meanings be designated by certain events. Language makes things become other precisely because it makes something that, in itself, is not a sign become a sign, and makes something that, in itself, is not a designated being become a designated being.

Humans are nevertheless convinced of what they say. They are convinced that they say what they want to say and that they say what they believe. But no matter what they say, they never say the incontrovertible: when they state that the firewood burns, they can be certain neither of what they say nor of what they want to say. Whenever they speak, even when they say that God does not exist or that everything can be doubted, an infinitely more abyssal doubt inhabits their speech. One states: “the firewood burns,” “God does not exist,” “I cannot doubt that I am doubting”; and yet, at the same time, each of these utterances can be doubted or negated, for it is not incontrovertible. The hyperbolic doubt itself, in doubting everything, does not doubt its own being-doubt: but how can the hyperbolic doubt be certain that it is doubting? How can it be certain that it doubts what it wishes to doubt? The “isolated earth” can only believe what it says; it can only will that what it says should mean what it is believed to mean. But every will is just a faith so long as it remains a controvertible will. Humans cannot know whether they do say what they want to say and whether they do want what they say they want. What is willed, what is believed, is the controvertible; but the controvertible cannot be the incontrovertible—what is. What humans say, no matter the language that they speak, is always something other than what is; what humans say, no matter the language that they speak, is always nothing. Every speech, every text, every system of signs that human beings have used to communicate has always communicated this nothingness. And saying this nothingness is altogether different from not saying anything—in the same way in which stating “the circle is square” is altogether different from not stating anything. No language and no testimony can rid itself of the doubt that inhabits it: the transcendental doubt that prevents it from being incontrovertibly certain of what it says and what it testifies to. At the same time, all languages and all testimonies cannot but wish (and therefore believe) to have rid themselves of this transcendental doubt—for otherwise they would not be able to utter a single word. Every human testimony isolates itself from this transcendental doubt, and in so doing it testifies to the controvertible: nothingness itself.

That something constitutes a language, for instance, the language of the Greeks, is a product of the interpreting will, through which the “given”—for example, the graphic event ánthropos—is transformed into a particular language. Even the existence of what Severino termed the “history of the West” and the very “history of the mortal,” which extends from prehistory to the history of the West, is something that emerges within the sphere of interpretation. This interpretation, based on specific rules, regards certain sets or events as signs of certain meanings. Interpretation is a relative concept: it always refers to something that is taken as the mere content of interpretation, though it is possible that, at a later stage, this very content should present itself as “laden” with theory and thus as the interpretation of something else. However, it is not possible that everything should be an interpretation:

If everything that appears were to appear as an interpretation, what is interpreted would not appear, and thus the interpretation itself, as such, would not be able to appear; that is to say, everything that appears would appear as a given (namely, in its not being interpreted).

It is therefore necessary that, originarily, “something” should appear that is not, in turn, an interpretation. This “something” can only be the earth as it reveals itself in the gaze of destiny.

Unlike the languages of the folly—that is, languages that affirm the becoming other of things (their becoming being and nothing)—the language that testifies to destiny speaks of the folly of becoming other. But as the will to “speak” of destiny, even the language that testifies to it belongs to that will to power, which constitutes the root of error. Insofar as it is the will for destiny to be a “designated,” that is, to be other than itself, the language that testifies to destiny constitutes a form of non-truth. Indeed, it is impossible for destiny to be other than itself. Yet destiny is not language, nor is it the language that speaks of destiny. Indeed, destiny is not the incontrovertible insofar as it is spoken, but insofar as it is that meaning which implies the self-negation of its own negation. And the language that testifies to it is truth insofar as “that” which it says is “that” whose negation negates itself.

e. The Apparatus of Science and Technics

The dimension of technics (a term that translates the Italian “tecnica,” and indicates every technical instance, rather than only that of modern technology) has an essential relation to the history of nihilism. In Plato’s Symposium, “[e]verything that is responsible for creating something out of nothing” and “[t]he productions of every téchne,” are described as kinds of poíesis (205b–c). Severino can assert that it is only insofar as a nihilistic conception of becoming is believed to be possible that the world may appear to be changed, transformed, created and destructed. Every will or agency that believes to enact a transformation of the world has a technical essence—and, therefore, a nihilistic one, for once again every transformation of the world may appear to take place only by believing that something-that-is will no longer be and something-that-is-not will begin to be: that is, only by believing that there is a time in which a being can be nothing. Conversely, from the standpoint of the truth of being, the different configurations that appear to be created and destructed are all always saved in their incontrovertible eternity.

The dimension of technics is not only the essence of the current age of the civilization that holds sway over the earth: the essence of technics permeates the entirety of the history of nihilism. Severino writes that “God is the first technician, and technics is the last God”—which is to say, on the one hand, God is already the guarantor of the existence of becoming and of the possibility of creating and destructing every secular being; technics (as the indefinite possibility of transforming the world after the “death of God”) is instead the only absolute self-evidence that cannot be questioned after the twilight of all the immutable dimensions of the age of metaphysics. However, both the metaphysical age and the non-metaphysical one (namely, the age in which humans believe that an immutable dimension is always safe and not subject to the becoming of the world, and the age in which humans believe that there can be no such immutable dimension) are grounded in the same belief in the existence of becoming and in the possibility of creating and destroying what is. That is, they are both grounded in the essence of nihilism—the essence of technics.

All the forces and agents that struggle for the dominion of the world, Severino argues, can only do so by empowering the very means through which they attempt to realize their ends, and these means precisely constitute what Severino refers to as the apparatus of science and technics—that set of forms of knowledge and praxis that make possible the indefinite increase in the transformability of the world. As part of this increase in the possibilities of transforming the world (that is, as part of the indefinite self-increase of the power of the apparatus of technics), humans strive to fend off the risk of death and pain as much as possible and increase the dimension of pleasure. Furthermore, there can be no abstract necessity why humanity should not come to believe that the possibilities of this apparatus have defeated that first and ultimate form of pain that is death itself, and thus realize what Severino refers to as the “paradise of technics”: the age in which humans will finally believe they are safe from that original danger that defines their existence. This analysis culminates in what may tentatively be described as Severino’s philosophical eschatology. Technological civilization appears to promise humanity a form of earthly salvation, overcoming suffering through unlimited scientific and technical power. Yet, Severino argues, this apparent paradise necessarily reverses into its opposite. Since technological power cannot establish the incontrovertible eternity of beings, the immortality it promises remains radically contingent. It therefore remains perpetually exposed to the possibility of annihilation. The more humanity entrusts itself to this technological promise of salvation, the more profoundly it experiences anguish, because what appears as definitive fulfillment is still understood as capable of becoming nothing. Humans will be confronted with the possibility of losing not only their lives, but also the very immortality that they believed they had obtained. Faced with the incommensurability of this anguish, they will need to confront what they believed to be the most certain form of self-evidence: the becoming of the appearing content. Only then will they be forced to look at the impossibility of their “isolated earth” and turn to the incontrovertible truth of the necessity of being.

6. Technical Elements

Several other lines of inquiry are explored in The Originary Structure:

The aporia of the meaning of nothingness. If the meaning of being appears to necessitate the meaning of nothingness as that which being is not (“being is not nothing”), does the very meaning of being imply the impossible existence of non-being itself—namely, the existence of that which being affirms does not exist? Concurrently, does the meaning of nothing imply something that is (self-identically) nothing (since nothing is nothing, rather than non-nothing)? The resolution of this age-old aporia constitutes one and the same achievement of the originary statement of the truth of being.
The meaning of dialectic. As part of the originary structure, the dialectical contradiction—specifically, the contradiction that takes place between a “concrete conception” and an “abstract conception” of an abstract meaning—is not solved at the end or as a result of a dialectical process (as in the Hegelian case, according to Severino’s reading of Hegel), but it precisely consists in the impossibility of any such process, transition or becoming. Every dialectical contradiction is originarily solved in and by the concrete self-identity of every being: that is, in and by the being’s belonging to the concrete totality of being, as part of which it is always already saved prior to any (impossible) becoming.
The relation between the finite and the infinite. The positing of the originary structure is a finite positing: it is a positing of the Whole as part of the finite dimension of appearing. The determinations of the originary structure are, indeed, concretely posited (that is, posited in their originary non-contradictoriness); insofar as the totality of the determinations is not posited (explain), however, the originary is still (self-) contradictory: it is a positing of the Whole that does not posit the Whole; it is a formal positing of the Whole; equivalently, it is only an intention of positing the Whole. This contradiction, however—the so-called “C-contradiction”—unlike a contradiction within a particular content, which is negated as part of the originary structure, is not superseded by negating a content or a meaning, but by augmenting the dimension that is posited as part of the originary. That is to say, the originary appearing of the concrete totality of being constitutes a contradiction that is superseded ad infinitum through the gradual appearing of the totality of being as part of the finite dimension (“circle”) of appearing. As such, the necessary superseding of the C-contradiction—the necessary appearing of the infinite as part of the finite—constitutes the “originary task.”

a. More about The Originary Structure

b. The Aporia of Nothing

As stated by Severino, the principle of non-contradiction requires the positing of non-being: being is not non-being; if this very non-being is not posited, being itself cannot be posited precisely as that which is opposite to non-being.

The “non-being” referred to in this definition is understood as that which is absolutely other than being. It is precisely this positing of non-being (as nihil absolutum) that raises a new aporetic situation: the formulation of the identity and non-contradiction of being, by implying the positing of non-being, seems to entail the contradictory assertion of the being of non-being, thus implying its own negation. Severino devotes considerable attention to this, as it represents one of the greatest difficulties encountered in the exposition of the originary structure. Here is how it is articulated:

Precisely insofar as it is excluded that being should be nothing—precisely in order for this impossibility to hold—nothingness itself is posited, or present, and it therefore is. There is a reasoning about nothingness, and this reasoning attests the being of nothingness; or, equivalently, there is a disclosure or awareness of nothingness, which attests its being. Accordingly, it appears that one should conclude that the ground upon which the very principle of non-contradiction may be realised consists of a contradiction.

The crucial observation consists in noting that that the meaning of nothingness is a self-contradictory meaning or a contradiction, not because nothingness, as such, means being, but because the absolute absence of meaning in nothingness (that is, its signifying as the absolute other than being) is positively signifying. Severino writes:

The contradiction of a non-being-that-is is not therefore internal to the meaning ‘nothingness’ (or to the meaning ‘being’ that is the being of nothingness), but it obtains between the meaning ‘nothingness’ and the being or positivity of this meaning. That is to say, the positivity of the signification is in contradiction with the very content of that signification, which is precisely meaningful as an absolute negativity.

The meaning of nothingness is a self-contradiction because the positivity (the “being”) of this meaning is contradicted by the absolute negativity of the signifying content, which is indeed signifying as that which is absolutely other than being. Two “moments” must therefore be identified within the self-contradiction of the meaning of nothing: the absolute negativity of the nihil absolutum, and the positive signification of this absolute lack of meaning or being. The self-contradiction of the meaning of nothing precisely consists in the contradiction between these two “moments”:

The absolutely other than being, qua other than being, is not a being; insofar as it is meaningful as the absolutely other than being, however, it is a being, or a positivity. […] The contradiction of ‘nothingness’ precisely lies in the fact that a meaningfulness is the meaningfulness of the absolutely meaningless: it does not lie in the fact that the meaningless means the meaningful […], but that the meaningless is meaningful as the meaningless.

The originary structure of knowledge reveals that everything asserted about nothingness, for example, that nothingness “is” nothing, is affirmed not because the absolute negative is something, but because the meaning of nothingness (which signifies the absolutely other than being) is positively significant. Its “being” (and everything said about nothingness) thus belongs to the structure of its positive signification: “‘Nothingness’, as a non-contradictory meaning, is a moment of ‘nothingness’ as a self-contradictory meaning.”

At this point, it becomes clear how the meaning of “nothing” appearing in the opposition between being and non-being should be understood:

The aporia of nothingness is resolved by noting that the principle of non-contradiction does not affirm the non-existence of the self-contradictory meaning […]; rather, it affirms that ‘nothingness’ does not mean ‘being’ […], i.e. it requires the non-existence of a contradiction in the meaning ‘nothingness’ that is a moment of the self-contradictory meaning. The non-being that appears in the formulation of the principle of non-contradiction as a negation of being is precisely a non-being that stands as a moment of non-being understood as a self-contradictory meaning.

If the self-contradicting meaning of nothingness did not exist, then nothingness would not appear at all, and it would not be possible to exclude its existence. However, this does not imply that the negation of the principle of non-contradiction is the condition for its establishment, but rather that this principle “constitutes itself insofar as nothingness obtains as a self-contradictory meaning.” The principle of non-contradiction does not deny the being of the positive signification of nothingness; it does not deny the appearing of the positive signification of nothingness, without which that principle could not be established, but it denies the being of nothingness.

The resolution of the aporia lies in recognizing the self-contradicting structure of the meaning of “nothing” and, at the same time, in the necessity of not separating the two moments of that meaning. Due to this separation, on the one hand, the “nothing moment” (the nothing that signifies nothing and non-being) is perceived as that self-contradictoriness which belongs to nothingness as a concrete meaning. On the other hand, nothingness is conceived as absolutely unrelated to the moment of positive signification. But nothingness continues to appear. If this were not the case, nothingness would remain ignored, and the aporetic discourse would not exist. Thus, it is a matter of understanding that, in the relation of contradiction, being excludes the absolute negativity of nothingness, whose meaning is distinct but not separate from its positive signification.

c. The Structure of Judgements

A non-contradictory statement is one that affirms the relationship of self-identity of a being, a relationship that is articulated in the form of the “identity of identity with itself.” This is a meaning of saying, and therefore of judgment, that is profoundly different from that present in traditional philosophical language, for which, instead, the “noetic” moment of the positing of a meaning precedes that of the relationship, and the latter appears as a result.

If the subject and the predicate are presupposed to the synthesis of judgment, in this very presupposition they are such that one is something to which the other does not yet belong, so that, with the arrival of the judgment, it occurs that “something which does not belong to the subject is said to belong to the subject.” As is well known, Hegel extended this difficulty even to tautological propositions, to the point where he could assert that every proposition is a contradiction: to express the identity A = A, the movement of reflection must go beyond A towards an “other,” a “different,” even if this difference “only appears as semblance, as an immediate vanishing,” since “the movement returns into itself.” Severino pushes this aporetic discourse even further, by showing that the contradiction “does not simply obtain between the ‘nullness’ and the ‘illusory being’ of the other of A, as claimed by Hegel, but between the nullness and the existence of the other of A. For, indeed, the A that appears as predicate is necessarily different from the A that appears as subject: otherwise, the identity between A and A would not be able to arise; that is, one would not be dealing with A = A, but simply with A.”

The contradiction inherent in all abstract judgments is resolved by recognizing that the subject is already, in itself, a synthesis of subject and predicate, and that the predicate is, in turn, already in synthesis with the subject. Equivalently, Severino asserts that the identity with itself of beings (A = A) has to be concretely conceived in these terms:

(A = A) = (A = A).

Analogously, propositions such as (A = B) must be intended as the identity with itself of the relation between A and B. As a formula we have:

(A = B) = (B = A).

For example, in asserting that “this extension” (A) is “red” (B), it is not possible to think of this extension as something separate (isolated) from its being “red.” If one presupposes its existence prior to being red, it becomes impossible to predicate redness of it. Thus, it must be of “this red extension” (A = B) that the predicate “red” is affirmed, and in turn, that being “red” is not separate from “this extension” but is the “being-red-of-this-extension” (B = A).

It remains established that the relationship between A and B must be understood as an identity with itself of the relationship (whence the necessity to conceive the elements of the relationship as inseparable). Severino can thus assert that only within the originary formulation of identity—concretely understood as the identity of identity with itself—can speaking and thinking be considered non-contradictory: “This means that all non-contradictory judgements are identical judgements, since in the case of ‘non-identical’ judgements, too, both the subject and the predicate of the judgement have the same apophantic value.”

The formulation (A = A) = (A = A) means that identity is not the result of a becoming that places A in relation to itself, but it is meaningful as something originary. It is not merely of the noema (A) that the being of A is affirmed, but of A that is identical to itself (that is, of A = A); where, once again, this latter A is not a mere noema (A) but is an A that is A (that is, A = A). Similarly, it can be stated that B pertains to an A that is originally in relation to B, and that the concrete formulation of this identity will be (A = B) = (B = A).

In Tautótes (1995), Severino returns to reflect on the meaning of “being” present in the formulation of identity of the type: A “is” B, and affirms: “If ‘being’—if the ‘is’ of ‘A is B ’—were a meaning that excludes identity, ‘being’ would mean ‘differing’, so that in thinking that A is B, one would think that A differs from B, that is, that A is not B.” Saying “this surface is white” does not mean saying that “this surface is whiteness.” On the other hand, if in the assertion “this surface (A) is white (B),” the copula did not also include in its meaning an identity, then it would signify “differing,” “non-identity,” so that, precisely while stating that “this surface is white,” one would be claiming that being-white pertains to a surface that is not white. This contradiction can be avoided only if, in saying that “this surface (A) is white (B),” the expression “this surface” is understood as a specific totality of determinations of which “being (this) white” is a part. The advance of Tautótes over The Originary Structure, where it was already stated that the assertion A = B is not contradictory only if conceived in the form of the self-identity of identity, namely (A = B) = (B = A), lies in the necessity of understanding A’s “being” B as the self-identity of A’s “being together” with B. In other words “Language continues to say that A is B; but it says the impossible. It says the impossible even if A = B is thought as (A = B) = (B = A). Only if beneath the linguistic form ‘A is B’ one thinks of A’s being together with B, can one continue to say that (A = B) = (B = A). The appropriate formula is therefore:

A = (together with B)] = [(together with B) = A.

d. The Theorem of the Glory and its Implications

The “Glory” of being is the necessity for the advent of the earth to never halt before any of the configurations that it gradually presents: it is the appearing of the necessity that each of the supervening beings be definitively surpassed, in such a way that the process of surpassing is destined to unfold infinitely. And since even the “solitude” of the earth, that is, its isolation from destiny, is an advent, the Glory is the appearing of the necessity that, at a certain point in this unfolding of beings, even the isolation of the earth be definitively and infinitely surpassed. Severino writes:

In its concrete meaning, the Glory is the infinite unfolding, within the finite circle of the appearing of destiny, of its having always already been unfolded in the infinite appearing of the Totality of being. The culmination of the Glory is thus the infinite unfolding of the earth beyond the solitude of the earth. And this unfolding is, on the one hand, eternal, already always accomplished; on the other hand, it continues to manifest itself infinitely within the finite circle of the appearing of destiny; and, finally, it now begins to be testified to by the language that testifies to destiny. Three aspects of the culmination of the Glory.

The “theorem” of the Glory shows the impossibility of a configuration of being that is both supervening and unsurpassable. If a determination that begins to appear were to find its unsurpassable place as part of the spectacle of appearing, such a supervening determination would be untranscendable: it would be something necessarily united to the background qua background, but, being a beginning entity, it would have been preceded by a time in which it was not united to the background qua background. In other words, it would be something that begins to necessarily belong to the background. This brings us to the essential trait of the foundation of the Glory:

A necessary union is […] one whose negation is something contradictory. But then, it is contradictory for the necessary union to be the result of the emergence of a certain being. It is contradictory for the necessary union to begin: that is, to be preceded by a time in which it does not exist. The union is necessary precisely because every situation in which that union is non-existent is contradictory. And it is, above all, contradictory that the being constituted by the necessary union should have been something non-existent—that is to say, a nothingness.

If the being that begins to appear were unsurpassable, this unsurpassability would be the beginning of its necessary relation to the background qua background. But a necessary union is such that there cannot be a time in which it does not exist, for every form of limitation of necessity is a negation of necessity. Several crucial implications follow from this “theorem.”

The first and most important one consists in the necessity of the end of the “isolation” of the earth: namely, in the end of the history of nihilism. If everything that begins to appear is destined to be surpassed, then even the isolation of the earth, insofar as it is something that begins—just as the earth itself, advancing into the circle of appearing, is something that begins—is destined to be surpassed. Precisely because the isolation of the earth is also something that begins, it is necessary that it too be surpassed. And this isolation is concretely surpassed only if what is surpassed—and entirely preserved in its appearing as something completed in all its parts—is the concrete totality of the isolated earth.

A second crucial implication of the “theorem” of the Glory concerns the assertion that, in the infinite unfolding of the determinations of the earth, the descent into oblivion of any such determination can never be a definitive and unsurpassable situation:

The absence of what descends into oblivion establishes the features of the face of what remains. If the oblivion were definitive, those features would be an ever-lasting mark—that is, an unsurpassable place where the path of the earth would come to a final halt. However, it is impossible that there should exist a place that the earth cannot surpass; it is therefore impossible for the isolation of the earth to definitively descend into oblivion.

The totality of what has arisen is therefore not only destined never to be annihilated but also never to descend forever into oblivion in any of its parts: that is, it is necessary for what has been forgotten to return into the circle of appearing and remain there definitively, not as unsurpassable, but as something surpassed. In other words, Severino asserts, it is necessary that everything that begins to appear (including the isolation of the earth) should be surpassed and at the same time totally preserved also in appearing, as well as in being. The definitive emergence from oblivion of the determinations of being (and their infinite remaining along the Glory of the earth) is therefore not an unsurpassable persistence because, unlike the persistence of the determinations of the “background”—which is that whose surpassing is impossible—in this form of supervening persistence, what persists does not persist in its being unsurpassable (which is impossible), but rather in its being infinitely surpassed.

A third, most significant implication of the “theorem” of the Glory consists in the affirmation of the existence of an infinite multiplicity of finite dimensions of appearing. The actuality of empirical appearing—that is, the appearing of the arriving configurations of the earth—is something that arrives. And since the self-being of being implies the necessity that the arriving entity be surpassed, it is necessary that even that which arrives as the actuality of the arriving entity be surpassed. That which surpasses the actuality of the beings that enter the circle of the original structure of destiny appears in that circle as an “abstract form,” in the sense that its necessary existence is affirmed. However, since it entails the surpassing of the actuality of the earth within the original circle, the surpassing being must be something that begins to appear within another circle of appearing—something that manifests itself according to a different actuality from that which pertains to the original circle of appearing. What has been said concerning the actuality of the original circle must also be said of the actuality of this other circle: indeed, the actuality (namely, the appearing) of what arrives within it cannot be something unsurpassable either, and its surpassing must refer to another circle, and then to yet another, ad infinitum. The finite circles of appearing are therefore infinite: Severino is able to prove the necessity of the existence of other “circles of appearing”—namely, the necessity of their belonging to the originary and incontrovertible structure of truth (thus providing an answer to the traditional question concerning the existence of a plurality of subjects).

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works in Italian

1958. ‘Aristotle and Classical Metaphysics’. Philosophy Today 2(2): 71–82.
1979. Legge e caso. Milan: Adelphi.
1980. Destino della necessità: Kata to chreon. Milan: Adelphi.
1978. Gli abitatori del tempo. Cristianesimo, marxismo, tecnica. Roma: Armando.
1979. Téchne. Le radici della violenza, Milano: Rusconi.
1981. La struttura originaria. Milan: Adelphi.
1982. Essenza del nichilismo. Milan: Adelphi.
1984. Studi di filosofia della prassi. Milan: Adelphi.
1985. Il parricidio mancato. Milan: Adelphi.
1988. La tendenza fondamentale del nostro tempo. Milan: Adelphi.
1989. Il giogo. Milan: Adelphi.
1989. La filosofia futura, Milano: Rizzoli.
1990. Il nulla e la poesia. Alla fine dell’età della tecnica: Leopardi. Milano: Rizzoli.
1992. Oltre il linguaggio. Milan: Adelphi.
1994. Heidegger e la metafisica. Milan: Adelphi.
1995. Tautótēs. Milan: Adelphi.
1998. Il destino della tecnica. Milano: Rizzoli.
1999. L’anello del ritorno. Milano: Adelphi.
2001. La Gloria. Milan: Adelphi.
2005. Fondamento della contraddizione. Milan: Adelphi.
2007. Oltrepassare. Milan: Adelphi.
2009. Il Destino della tecnica. Milan: BUR Rizzoli.
2011. La morte e la terra. Milan: Adelphi.
2012. Capitalismo senza futuro. Milan: Rizzoli
2013. Intorno al senso del nulla. Milan: Adelphi.
2015. Dike. Milan: Adelphi.
2016. Storia, gioia. Milan: Adelphi.
2019. Testimoniando il destino. Milan: Adelphi.

b. Primary Readings Translated into English

2016. The Essence of Nihilism, ed. Alessandro Carrera and Ines Testoni, trans. Giacomo Donis. London: Verso.
2016. Nihilism and Destiny, ed. Nicoletta Cusano. Milan: Mimesis International.
2023. Law and Chance, ed. Giulio Goggi, Damiano Sacco, Ines Testoni, transl. Damiano Sacco. London: Bloomsbury
2024. Beyond Language, ed. Giulio Goggi, Damiano Sacco, Ines Testoni, trans. Damiano Sacco. London: Bloomsbury.
2025. The Originary Structure, ed. And transl. Damiano Sacco (London: Bloomsbury).
2026. The Fundamental Tendency of our Time, transl. Antimo Lucarelli (London: Bloomsbury).
2026. War: Violence and Technics in the West, transl. Federico Divino (London: Bloomsbury).
2026. Tautótes: On the Western Meaning of Identity, transl. Antimo Lucarelli London: Bloomsbury).

c. Secondary Readings

Barbera, Giovanni. 2023. La voce disgiuntiva dell’essere. Sull’opera di Emanuele Severino nell’interpretazione di Gabriele Pulli (Napoli: Liguori Editore).
Cacciari, Massimo. 2023. Metafisica concreta (Milano: Adelphi), 301–306.
Cusano, Nicoletta. 2025. Il nulla e la determinazione (Milano: Mimesis).
Donà, Massimo. 2023. Di fantasmi, incantesimi e destino. Emanuele Severino ultimo calligrafo della verità (Roma: Inschibboleth).
Farotti, Fabio. 2023. Il nichilismo perfetto (e l’Io del destino: la Gloria, la Gioia), (Padova: Padova University Press).
Farotti, Fabio. 2024. Gustare il destino nel cristianesimo (Padova: Padova University Press).
Fiocco, M. Oreste. 2023. “Existence Is No Thing: Existence, Fixity and Transience,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 5, no. 8 (December): 43–68.
Goggi, Giulio. 2021. “Aristotle’s Aporia and the Thought that Looks at Nothing,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 3, no. 4 (April): 81–99.
Goggi, Giulio. 2022. “The Identity and Eternity of Every Being,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 4, no. 7 (December): 80–99.
Goggi, Giulio. 2026. Emanuele Severino: The Philosopher of Eternity, transl. Federico Divino (London: Bloomsbury).
Graziani, Ernesto, and Francesco Orilia. 2023. “Severino as a Temporarist Static Eternalist,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 5, no. 8 (December): 99–120.
Lando, Giorgio. 2023. “Facts for Necessitists and Permanentists,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 5, no. 8 (December): 69–98.
Lucarelli, Antimo. 2021. Per un nuovo concetto di fenomeno: Muovendo da Heidegger e Severino (Soveria Mannelli: Rubbettino).
Messinese, Leonardo. 2025. Emanuele Severino. Il destino e il mortale (Milano: Feltrinelli).
Priest, Graham. 2020. “Emanuele Severino and the Principle of Non-Contradiction,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 2, no. 2 (February): 42–66.
Priest, Graham. 2021. “Severino on Nothing,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 3, no. 4 (April): 114–122.
Rienzi, Marco. 2023. Emanuele Severino. Con l’Occidente oltre l’Occidente (Roma: Inschibboleth).
Sacco, Damiano. 2023. “Emanuele Severino: A Testimony of the Language that Testifies to Destiny” in Journal of Italian Philosophy, Vol. 6, 95-116.
Severino, Emanuele, and Roger Penrose. 2022. “A Dialogue on Natural Intelligence Versus Artificial Intelligence,” in Artificial Intelligence Versus Natural Intelligence, ed. Fabio Scardigli (Switzerland: Springer), 27–70.
Stella, Aldo. 2018. Il concetto di «relazione» nell’opera di Severino. A partire da «La struttura originaria» (Milano: Guerini e Associati).
Stella, Aldo. 2019. “Metafisica originaria” in Severino. Precisazioni preliminari e approfondimenti tematici (Milan: Guerini e Associati).
Tarquini, Nicolò. 2023. Eternità e divenire. Emanuele Severino e la metafisica classica (Nocera: Orthotes).
Testoni, Ines. 2020. “Metaphilosophical Sketches between Emanuele Severino and Graham Priest,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 2, no. 2 (February): 31–41.
Testoni, Ines. 2022. “Beyond Alienation: Severino’s Removal of Pathological Contradiction,” in «Eternity & Contradiction», vol. 4, no. 7 (December): 45–60.

Author Information

Ines Testoni
Email: ines.testoni@unipd.it
University of Padua
Italy

and

Damiano Sacco
Email: damiano.sacco.d@gmail.com
University of Padua
Italy

and

Goggi Giulio
Email: ggoggi@libero.it
University of Padua
Italy

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy