The Socratic Method

According to Socrates, for a human being the unexamined life is not worth living. This claim rings familiar to many. It is the sort of thing that might be printed on a t-shirt or as a bumper sticker on a car. But what does it mean? Do people who do not examine their lives but spend their time caring for the poor not live worthwhile lives? Is it not better to do good things than to think about them? Socrates’ life’s motto seems obvious and elevating when one first hears it but quite strange upon deeper thought.

When Socrates declares that the unexamined life is not worth living, he recommends the pursuit of philosophy. The examined life is for him a matter of philosophical dialogue. Does this make his claim sound even more ridiculous? Could the worthwhile life for a human being really involve talking about truth, being, and perception, rather than having a satisfying job, a family, and serving one’s community? Even Plato seems to say that most philosophers are cranks, if not completely useless.

According to another familiar saying, actions speak louder than words—to know people one should look at what they do, not what they say. Yet the most striking thing about Socrates is that he spent most of his life in conversation. His life was a unity of speech and deed, for what he did was talk. Socrates’ activity of speech was in particular a relentless questioning of others—this is his famous method. To understand what it means to live an examined life, one must understand the Socratic method.

Scholars have written much about Socrates’ method. What are its goals? What kind of arguments does Socrates use? Does he cheat or use unfair tactics? The discussion becomes technical and the method sometimes seems to evaporate into thin air. Yet this characteristic of the scholarship seems to mirror Socrates’ own approach to conversation, which begins with ordinary matters such as talking to an old man about getting old, or educating children, and ends up traversing topics that are both fundamental and arcane. Socrates’ way of speaking is both ordinary and technical, simple and profound. In the end, Socrates’ main point is, perhaps, just this: the best human life is one in which one keeps on learning about morality and how to live. Without learning, one cannot grow. And what learning requires above all is asking questions, not being complacent, and not assuming that one already knows how to live or what morality requires. Like many things in life, the simplest is also the most difficult.

Introduction
The Socrates of Plato’s Dialogues
Plato’s Definitional Dialogues
Plato’s Non-Definitional Dialogues
Are There Many Socratic Methods?
Evaluating Socrates’ Method
1. Socrates as Serious Inquirer
2. Socrates as Ironical Inquirer
Socratic Self-Reflections
The Apology of Socrates
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. The Historical Socrates
2. Plato’s Socrates

1. Introduction

The Socratic method is a spoken philosophical dialogue. It is called “Socratic” on account of its association with a historical figure: Socrates, especially as he is depicted by Plato in written dialogues.

Socrates was a citizen of Athens. He was born in 470 B.C. His father, Sophroniscus, was a stone mason; his mother, Phaenarete, a midwife, the significance of which is discussed in section 7b. Socrates was conspicuously ugly by the standards of the time, with a snub nose and bulging eyes. People said that he resembled a satyr, a mythical companion of Dionysus, half-human and half-goat. Since he spent his days conversing with people in the public spaces and private homes of Athens, he was very poor. Nevertheless, he served in the military and went to war for his city, fighting bravely; he also served as a judge. In erotic matters, Socrates had a reputation for seeking out the company of beautiful young men. More privately, he got married to a woman named Xanthippe and had at least three children. Socrates died in 399 B.C. This was officially an execution by drinking hemlock, a penalty for his conviction of capital crimes, namely, corrupting the youth and introducing new gods into the city. But Socrates lived and died on his own terms, and Plato’s Phaedo depicts his death as voluntary, not forced; it is more of a suicide than an execution.

The historical Socrates was literate in that he could read and write. However, he did not write books like other philosophers but seems to have spent his adult life in conversation—that is, practicing the Socratic method. The primary sources for knowledge of Socrates’ method are Aristophanes, Xenophon and Plato. Aristophanes was a comic playwright who lampooned Socrates in his play entitled the Clouds. Xenophon and Plato were, by contrast, writers of literary compositions that represent or imitate Socratic dialogues. Other writers worked in this genre too—the so-called “minor Socratics”; however, their writings survive only in fragments and testimonia. This article focuses on Plato’s representation of the Socratic method. Readings on Xenophon and the minor Socratics are presented in the bibliography.

In thinking about the Socratic method, it is useful to have a simple framework, a set of two guiding questions. The first question that can be asked about Socrates’ method is about its form, or what it is. Answering this question requires specifying the goals and the means of the dialogue and explaining how they relate to one another. To put this more concretely—is it a method of inquiry or refutation? Does it proceed by questioning, argument, or some other type of discourse? How does reasoning of this type advance the goals of the dialogue? For example, some scholars believe that Socrates argued in order to establish the truth, whereas others emphasise his questioning.

The second guiding question is whether the Socratic method is a good method of reasoning. To answer this requires determining whether his goals are desirable, whether he achieves them fairly, and what the effects of his approach might be. More precisely—if Socrates searches for knowledge, does he find what he is looking for? If he seeks to teach or refute, does he achieve what he intends and, if so, does he use legitimate means? For example, are those whom he engages benefited by his method or merely aggravated and perplexed? Finally, does Socrates use transparent means and, if not, can his irony be justified?

This article offers a framework for reconstructing Socrates’ method and a survey of the positions that scholars have taken on its nature, value, and effectiveness.

2. The Socrates of Plato’s Dialogues

A dialogue is a talk exchange about any topic—for example, a conversation about politics or the weather. More narrowly, it is a literary composition that represents a spoken dialogue. This sense includes dialogues of Plato, as well as others such as Cicero, Leibniz, and Hume.

Scholars often read Plato’s dialogues chronologically. There are the early works representing the historical Socrates, as opposed to middle and late dialogues expressing Plato’s own views. An alternative method focuses not on relative date of composition but the dramatic relationships between Socrates’ conversations. For example, while the Euthyphro is an early dialogue, the Cratylus a middle, and the Theaetetus a middle or late, the drama of the three dialogues is connected: Socrates leaves the discussion with Theaetetus to go to King Archon’s court, where he encounters Euthyphro; the Cratylus suggests that Socrates had spoken to Euthyphro that same day. This article does not assume a sharp distinction between dialogues expressing Socratic as opposed to Platonic views.

The majority of Plato’s writings depict Socrates engaged in conversation, but not all do. Socrates is wholly absent from Plato’s Laws, and in the Sophist, Statesman and Timaeus, he appears largely as a bystander. Conversely, Socrates speaks at length in the Apology but does not really engage in dialogue—instead he delivers three forensic speeches and cross-examines one of his prosecutors. The extent to which this cross-examination corresponds with his usual method is debated by scholars.

Socrates’ dialogues are almost always conducted in the format of short question-and-answer. In fact, he usually insists that interlocutors adopt this way of conversing, criticising sophists and rhetoricians for their use of long, showy speeches. Although he is sometimes willing to assume the role of answerer, he is almost always the questioner.

Socrates’ method of question-and-answer is a vehicle for dialectical argumentation. This means argument in which philosophical ideas are presented, opposed, and revised. The examination usually goes through several rounds as interlocutors change their positions in response to Socrates’ questions and objections. The character of this reasoning is discussed in more detail in sections 3 and 4.

Plato’s dialogues show Socrates discussing a variety of topics. These include poetic inspiration, the immortality of the soul, linguistic convention, the nature of virtue or specific virtues, the teachability and unity of virtue, friendship, the best political community, and whether it is better to do justice or to suffer it.

One important subset of Plato’s writings are definitional dialogues. These are conversations in which Socrates poses a question of the form “What is X?” Most often, he asks for a definition of virtue, either in general (Meno) or one of the cardinal virtues such as courage (Laches), justice (Republic book 1), temperance (Charmides), or piety (Euthyphro); in the Theaetetus, he requests a definition of knowledge, analysed as a type of wisdom. However, the relevant X is not always what would be regarded as a virtue—in the possibly spurious Hippias Major, Socrates discusses beauty; in the Lysis, he asks for an account of friendship, or the friend. He is also interested in defining supposed “arts” (technai), such as sophistry and rhetoric.

In other Platonic dialogues, Socrates and companions refrain from discussing definitions. For example, they present etymologies (Cratylus), give rhetorical speeches (for example, Phaedrus and Symposium) or, most commonly, discuss the truth of substantive philosophical or ethical claims (see, for example, Gorgias and Protagoras). Socrates’ method sometimes changes overtly from definitional inquiry to substantive argumentation. For example, the first book of the Republic is a mixed dialogue—what begins as an inquiry into the nature of justice turns into a debate about whether it is better than injustice.

Socrates seems to think that the definitional dialogues are more fundamental than the rest. The reason is his principle of the priority of definition (hereafter, PD), according to which knowing instances or attributes of virtue requires being able to define it. For example, knowing that holding one’s ground in battle is courageous requires being able to say what courage is (see Laches); knowing whether it is just to pay one’s debts requires being able to define justice (see Republic), and so on. PD thus explains why Socrates centres his inquiries on the “What is X?” question. It also explains why he concludes several non-definitional and mixed dialogues by recommending definitional discussion.

Many scholars judge PD to be implausible or false, and this notion has a name to reflect this: the Socratic Fallacy. Nevertheless, given Socrates’ clear use of PD to differentiate between definitional and non-definitional dialogues or sections of dialogue, these will be treated separately. The Socratic Fallacy will be discussed further in section 6.

3. Plato’s Definitional Dialogues

As already noted, the Socrates of Plato’s definitional dialogues asks a question of the form “What is X?”. His method is to this extent an inquiry: it is an attempt to learn a definition of virtue or a related good such as beauty. For terminological convenience, the qualifier “or a related good” will be omitted from now on. Reference will be to Socrates’ definitional dialogues on virtue.

Socrates does not conduct his inquiries by empirical observation or by reasoning things out for himself. His usual approach is to learn from authorities, that is, people who claim to know the nature of virtue, what virtue is or, at least, who are presented as knowing. Socrates begins his conversations assuming that they will be able to answer his definitional question by giving an articulate account.

Some scholars and, indeed, interlocutors, take Socrates’ questioning stance to be a ruse—it is mere pretence, part of his characteristic irony. One reason for their view is that Socrates invariably refutes his interlocutors’ proposed answers. This makes it difficult to believe that he regards them as genuine authorities. In fact, the Socratic method is sometimes dubbed the elenchus (or elenchos)—from the Greek elenchein, to refute or to shame. Although this term is widely used by scholars, Socrates never calls his method “elenchus”, and the term prejudges it as a type of refutation.

This article frames the question of Socratic irony in terms of a distinction between formal and material goals. To understand this distinction, consider a rhetorical question. A rhetorical question can be defined as one in which a speaker uses interrogative grammar to achieve something other than, even contrary to, what is usually accomplished with a sentence of this type. For example, when somebody says, “is the sky blue?”, she does not seek to learn anything, but employs a grammatical question to claim that something is obvious. The speaker’s material goal or intended effect (making a claim of obviousness) is thus different from the formal goal implied by the interrogative grammar of the sentence (eliciting information).

This distinction can be applied to the Socratic method in the following way. Socrates’ formal goal in the definitional dialogues is specified by his “what is X?” question: it is to learn what virtue or some specific virtue might be. This stance of inquiry is embedded in Socrates’ dialogue more generally, too—for example, in his familiar disavowal of knowledge, his assertion of a desire to learn from the interlocutor, and the content of secondary or follow-up questions.

Socrates’ material goal is the intended effect of his discourse—what he wishes to accomplish by his stance of inquiry, that is, discourse expressing the formal goal implied by the “what is X?” question. To the extent that Socrates asks a definitional question, he behaves like a person who seeks information, but one can ask questions for reasons other than learning. For example, one might ask questions to determine whether people can answer them, that is, in a test, or even to amuse, irritate and confound.

If Socrates’ formal and material goals align with one another, then he can be regarded as a serious inquirer. This would be somebody who asks the question “what is X?” in order to learn what X is. By contrast, if his material goal or goals were different from, even contrary to, his formal goal, then his method would be characterised by irony—for example, asking “What is X?” to teach or refute interlocutors. The relationship between such goals and higher-order ends such as protreptic ends—that is, exhorting people to philosophy—is discussed in a later section.

a. Socrates’ Formal Goals

Socrates’ formal goals determine the form of his reasoning, that is, its logical or argumentative structure. For example, if he were seeking to demonstrate something, he should employ arguments, but if he were trying to learn from others, questions would be the appropriate tools to use. When considered in this way, there are two main accounts of the form of the Socratic method in the scholarship.

According to Gregory Vlastos’ constructive theory of the elenchus, the goal of Socrates’ method is to prove something, and the form of his reasoning—what Vlastos calls the “elenchus”—is an argument that proceeds from the interlocutors’ beliefs to the contradiction of their initial assertion. More specifically, the constructive theory of the elenchus is as follows:

1. [An] interlocutor asserts a thesis, p, which Socrates considers false and targets for refutation.
2. Socrates secures agreement to further premises, say q and r (each of which may stand for a conjunct of propositions). The agreement is ad hoc: [he] argues from his premises, not to them.
3. Socrates then argues, and the interlocutor agrees, that q & r entail not-p.
4. [He] then claims that he has shown that not-p is true, [so] p [is] false (1994, p. 11).

The constructive model is not widely accepted by scholars for several reasons. In the first place, Socrates’ definitional dialogues are governed by a “what is X?” question—they are, formally speaking, inquiries. Yet the constructive model represents the Socratic method as a type of demonstration or argument. In a related vein, Socrates’ interlocutors do not assert a thesis out of the blue; they try to answer a question about the nature of virtue. If the constructive model describes the argumentation that Socrates advances in response to this answer, then it describes his method only in part.

Another objection to the constructive model is that it distorts the argumentative part of Socrates’ method as it appears in the definitional dialogues (the model does much better when applied to the predicative dialogues; see section 4). Since these encounters never conclude with agreement on an answer to the “What is X?” question, it is inaccurate to say that Socrates proves the contradictory of the interlocutor’s assertion (schematically, not-p). At most he infers that the interlocutor has not provided a satisfactory account of the relevant X: for example, courage is not endurance, temperance is not a sense of shame, and so on.

A second attempt to articulate the structure of the Socratic method is the non-constructive account. It is presented by Hugh Benson as follows:

(1) Socrates asks the interlocutor a question the answer to which is meant to exhibit the interlocutor’s wisdom usually, but not always, concerning the definition of some moral concept. [The interlocutor’s initial answer, which Benson refers to as the apparent refutand can be symbolised by p.]

(2) the interlocutor provides answers, q, r, and s to a series of other Socratic questions.

(3) Socrates goes on to show that these answers entail the negation of the original answer.

Thus, (4) the conjunction p & q & r & s is false. (2011, p. 184)

The non-constructive theory seems superior to the constructive account in that it presents Socrates as engaged in a type of inquiry—not so much into the subject matter as the interlocutor’s understanding of it. He uses his primary “what is X?” question to answer another one, namely, “does this person know what X is?”. Another way to frame this point is that Socrates seeks to examine his interlocutors’ pretension to wisdom.

A more general objection that applies to both the constructive and non-constructive models of Socrates’ method is that they use symbolism that misrepresents the logic of the definitional dialogues. The variables p, q, r, and so on express logically unarticulated propositions, but Socrates is concerned with the question “what is X?”. For this reason, the interlocutor’s answer is better symbolised as follows:

X =_df …

With this in mind, the logic of Socrates’ method in one type of exchange can be expressed as follows. In response to Socrates’ “what is X?” question, the interlocutor proposes a definition of the following type:

X =_df S

For example, temperance is a sense of shame.

In response to further questions, the interlocutor admits that some instances of S (for example, a sense of shame) are not instances of X (temperance). Formulated as a claim of set membership, this can be represented as follows:

∃e₁ (e₁ ∈ S ∧ e₁ ∉ X)

From this, it is inferred that:

(3) ~ (X =_df S)

In plain English, the interlocutor’s proposed definition is defective because it is too broad.

This is, of course, not the only style of argument that Socrates uses. In other cases, he seeks to show that the proposed definition is too narrow, fails to identify an essence, and so on. The key point is that he neither argues that some specific claim is true nor that the conjunction of propositions introduced by the interlocutor’s admissions is inconsistent. Instead, he asserts or suggests that the account does not satisfactorily define X. The principles of definition that he uses to support these claims will be discussed further in section 3b.

A third, more recent, interpretation of the Socratic method is the exegetical theory. This position emphasises the distinction between logic and pragmatics—whereas the former is concerned with the formal relationships between propositions, the latter studies how meaning is shaped by context, intentions, and conversational norms.

It is widely accepted that Socrates ascribes knowledge to his interlocutors—he assumes, perhaps ironically, that they are authorities about the relevant subject matter. According to the exegetical theory, Socrates’ attribution of knowledge, his epistemic assumption, must be taken seriously, for it controls the development of the argument. In contradistinction with the non-constructive model, his question is not “does this person know what X is?” but “has this person articulated his knowledge of virtue?” On this view, then, Socrates does not take the refutation of an account to imply that the interlocutor does not know—instead he assumes that he has not said what he knows.

According to the exegetical account, the Socratic method in a definitional dialogue proceeds as follows:

1. Socrates ascribes knowledge of virtue to his interlocutor; he asks a question that invites him to express this knowledge in a definition.
2. In response, the interlocutor puts forward an account: X =_df …
3. Socrates then relies on assumptions about virtue or principles of definition to argue that the account is incorrect or incomplete: ~ (X =_df …).
4. From this he infers, not that the interlocutor does not know, but that he has not stated what he knows.
5. Finally, Socrates encourages him to try again to articulate his knowledge of virtue. (See Futter 2025, 136-137)

One central question for the exegetical model is whether it faithfully represents what is depicted in Plato’s dialogues. Does not Socrates sometimes judge that interlocutors such as Euthyphro are ignorant of what virtue is? This question and the more general significance of Socrates’ epistemic assumption—his indefeasible attribution of knowledge to the interlocutor—will be discussed further in the next section.

Finally, it is noteworthy that some scholars deny the existence of the Socratic method—on their reading, Socrates’ method has no distinctive form; it is, at most, an interconnected array of argumentative techniques and goals. Since the credibility of the sceptical view seems to derive from an inability to find a unity in Socrates’ discourses, it will not be discussed further—readers are asked to determine for themselves whether the accounts of the unity of the Socratic method presented in this article have merit.

b. Socrates’ Principles of Definition

When Socrates asks a question of the “What is X?” type, interlocutors usually attempt to answer it. However, Socrates is never satisfied with their answers, and he always seeks to show that these are incorrect or at least incomplete. In this vein, it is worth noting that he sometimes targets interpretations of his interlocutor’s account, rather than the account itself. For example, his refutation of the proposal that justice is giving to each what is fitting in the Republic is directed against a specific interpretation—helping friends and harming enemies. Yet it seems clear that this view could be developed in a different and better way.

Socrates often relies on substantive claims about the nature of virtue in his refutations of the proposed accounts. One of the most significant is the claim that virtue is always good and beautiful, a position that he often ascribes to his interlocutors—he suspects, in other words, that this is something they already accept. Socrates rejects accounts of virtue that do not accommodate this datum. For example, in the Laches, he argues that courage cannot be endurance because it is always beautiful (or noble), whereas endurance is sometimes ugly (or ignoble).

Socrates’ arguments also rest on several claims about the nature of definition. Since discussion of this topic is quite technical, this article will seek to provide a broad overview. For further detail, see the references to Dancy, Benson, Forster, and Wolfsdorf presented in the bibliography.

One principle of definition that Socrates seems to accept is that a definition must be unified—it should be a “one” rather than a “many”. He uses this principle in the Meno to dismiss the suggestion that there are different kinds of virtue for different people occupying different social roles. This is to provide a swarm of virtues, not a unity that runs through them all.

Secondly, a definition must specify a characteristic that is coextensive with the definiendum (this can be referred to as the requirement for extensional equivalence)—it should be neither too narrow nor too broad. For this reason, a single type of action cannot define virtue, as it can be expressed in many different deeds; similarly, definitions appealing to a manner of performance are inadequate since they are too broad; for example, temperance is not doing things quietly as some quiet actions are not temperate (Charmides).

Thirdly, while extensional equivalence is necessary for a definition, it is not sufficient. A definition must also identify an essence rather than an accidental or a surface feature. This point is explained in the Euthyphro: piety cannot be defined as what all the gods love even if all and only pious things are loved by the gods (extensional equivalence)—the reason is that being loved by the gods is something that happens to a thing, not something that it is.

Socrates also imposes certain epistemic constraints of definition: for example, the account should not be circular, that is, making reference to a term that is presupposed by definiendum (for example, defining virtue in terms of doing things justly, as justice is a part of virtue). Moreover, the definition must be informative—it must help someone who does not know what is sought to come to know it (see Meno). This makes definition sensitive to the interlocutor’s state of knowledge: for example, it would disqualify a definition of colour in terms of light if the person to whom the account was presented happened to be blind.

What kind of definition, if any, could satisfy these principles? Socrates seems sympathetic to accounts that identify a genus and a distinguishing characteristic. For example, in the Euthyphro, he suggests that piety is a proper part of justice: though all pious things are just, the converse is not true. Moreover, he seems at least sympathetic to Euthyphro’s suggestion that piety is the part of justice concerned with care for the gods. Likewise, the Socrates of Laches does not reject the suggestion that courage is a kind of wisdom or knowledge. Instead, it seems that this wisdom has not been articulated. For these reasons, it appears that a definition of virtue as a kind of knowledge might be able to satisfy Socrates’ principle. This question will be discussed further in section 3d.

c. Socrates’ Material Goals

Socrates typically puts himself forward as a learner, somebody who seeks an answer to a “what is X?” question. Yet, as observed earlier, the adoption of a questioning stance can be rationalised by ends contrary to learning—for example, refutation or teaching. It thus seems necessary to consider the intended effects, or material goals, of Socrates’ questioning in more detail. In other words, what does Socrates seek to accomplish by means of his standpoint of definitional questioning?

To begin, it is worth drawing a distinction between the self- and other-regarding dimensions of Socrates’ discourse, that is, between what he seeks to accomplish for himself as opposed to what he seeks for others. The latter has a clear therapeutic dimension—his method seeks to cultivate the interlocutor in a certain way. This is the Socratic art of psychagogia, soul-leading, or caring for the soul.

Some candidates for Socrates’ self-regarding material goals (what he seeks to achieve for himself) are as follows:

1. Learning what virtue is.
2. Learning what the interlocutor thinks that virtue is.
3. Assuring himself that nobody knows what virtue is.
4. Assuring himself that everyone knows what virtue is.
5. Developing his own capacity for dialogue.
6. Unifying his soul in relation to the end of inquiry.

It is worth noting that if (1) specifies Socrates material goal then his formal and material goals will coincide. By contrast, (2)-(6) are goals that Socrates could pursue with, or by means of, definitional questioning—they might be described as byproducts or higher-order goals.

Candidates for Socrates’ other-regarding goals (what he wants to produce in interlocutors) are as follows:

1. Examining the interlocutor’s knowledge of the subject matter.
2. Refuting his interlocutor’s accounts of virtue.
3. Refuting the interlocutor’s claim to know.
4. Guiding the interlocutor to a better account of, or way of thinking about, virtue.
5. Helping the interlocutors to recognise that they cannot say what they know.
6. Motivating the interlocutor to search for wisdom.
7. Cultivating the interlocutor’s virtue.

Not all of these stated goals are mutually exclusive—Socrates could pursue some of them concurrently or as means to the attainment of others. For example, he might seek to assure himself that interlocutors do not know and, at the same time, to engender openness to, and a disposition for, inquiry. Openness to inquiry would then be a higher-order psychagogic material goal, pursued by refuting specific accounts of virtue.

d. The Relationship between Socrates’ Formal and Material Goals

Socrates’ way of speaking is often thought to be characterised by irony—for example, he describes his interlocutors as “wise” and “clever” even when they appear unable to answer his questions. As noted earlier, this article frames the question of irony in terms of a possible discrepancy between Socrates’ formal and material goals—in short, whether he uses the “what is X?” question to learn what X is or for some contrary reason.

According to the constructive theory, Socrates’ formal goal in dialogue is to prove the truth of a proposition. Since this account evidently misdescribes his practice (see section 3a), it can be set aside. According to the non-constructive theory, Socrates asks the definitional question to determine whether the interlocutor knows what X is and, if he is judged not to know, to refute him. Since the attempt to learn from interlocutors is distinct from, and opposed to, acts of determining whether they are authorities, or refuting them, Socrates’ formal and material goals are misaligned. Likewise, the exegetical theory maintains that Socrates seeks to learn what virtue is but always engages in refutation—not of the claim that the interlocutor has knowledge but of specific accounts of its content. For this reason, his formal goal of learning seems contrary to his material goals.

An account of the relationship between Socrates’ formal and material goals must pay attention to the structure of his refutations. As mentioned earlier, Socrates’ arguments depend on claims about the nature of virtue and definition—for example, a definition must refer to a one, not a many, identify an essence rather than a surface feature, and preserve the goodness and beauty of virtue across all contexts. Given such assumptions, it appears that Socrates’ uses his refutative arguments to guide interlocutors to a specific account of virtue as a kind of knowledge. Knowledge of what is in fact good appears to be the only characteristic that could satisfy his criteria on definition—everything else that might be presented as definitive of virtue is good and beautiful only on occasion and in part.

According to some commentators, Socratic refutation does not merely proceed at the conceptual or argumentative level—he also engages in soul-leading (psychagogia), that is, the attempt to cultivate good character. If the dialogue moves towards an equation of virtue with knowledge, then Socrates will presumably try to instil knowledgeable dispositions of soul in interlocutors. A fuller account of the material dimension of his method would have to show how he uses questions to modify the interlocutors’ desires, emotions, and forms of attention—in short, it would have to explain how he guides them to wisdom as a state of being.

4. Plato’s Non-Definitional Dialogues

In the terminology adopted in this article, Socrates’ definitional dialogues are governed by a “What is X?” question. These may be contrasted with other, non-definitional, dialogues. One significant subset within this latter group is conversations that address a question of the type “is X F?”—for example, “is virtue teachable?” or “is justice advantageous to its possessor?”. Questions of this type are labelled predicative questions.

Definitional and predicative questions have a different logical character. Whereas the former are logically open, admitting of an unlimited number of possible answers, the latter are closed—that means either affirming or denying a proposition (yes-or-no questions) or selecting one out of two or more options (for example, either-or questions). To illustrate the difference: Plato’s Phaedo invites an affirmative answer to the question “is the soul immortal?”, whereas the Ion asks whether the rhapsode’s art is a matter of skill or divine inspiration.

In contradistinction with definitional dialogues, Socrates seems to take a clear position on what he regards as the correct answer to the predicative question. For example, as shown by the Gorgias, he evidently judges it to be better to suffer injustice than to commit it; a similar point applies in the Republic. Moreover, the adversarial dimension is often accentuated—even though the question-and-answer format is retained, the dialogue is more of a debate than a discussion.

Socrates’ formal goal in these exchanges appears to be to establish the truth or falsity of a given proposition. This is to say that he advances reasoning that seeks to affirm or deny F (or F-ness) of something, where F is often one of a pair of contraries, F or G—for example, just or unjust, beautiful or ugly, better or worse. To say that F and G are contraries means that it is not possible for something to be both F and G concurrently and in the same respects, though it can be neither.

Plato’s non-definitional dialogues are often brilliant works of drama, with memorable imagery and myth (for example, Gorgias and Protagoras). Moreover, they have a thematic unity inasmuch as Socrates argues for the unity of virtue, or the superiority of justice over injustice. At the level of method, however, these dialogues often embody a familiar type of argumentation that seeks to establish a proposition about virtue. If there is anything distinctive about Socrates’ approach here, it is that he tries to secure the interlocutors’ agreement to each step in the reasoning, and interprets conclusions as expressing their deep or true beliefs. To this extent, the argument seeks to be “dialectical” or “conversational”—not in the sense of proceeding by opposition, but from the interlocutor’s own convictions.

As observed in the preceding section, Socrates’ definitional inquiry can be related to different material goals—however, “related to” does not mean compatible with, since the linkage is often one of incongruity. A similar point applies to the predicative dialogues. If Socrates’ formal goal were proof and his material goal persuasion, then his formal and material goals would be aligned. Higher-order material goals such as consolation or moral edification would flow from states of belief or acceptance. By contrast, Socrates could use discourse with the formal goal of establishing the truth of a proposition to accomplish something contrary to proof—for example, jarring the interlocutor’s sense of complacency. This appears to be what is happening in dialogues such as Hippias Minor and the Ion, in which Socrates’ positive arguments are quite playful. In the latter, for example, Socrates tries to persuade Ion that he is crazy and out of his mind when he interprets Homer (Ion 535d–e, 536d).

5. Are There Many Socratic Methods?

Given the results thus far, Socrates’ approach to dialogue can be reduced to two forms—first, definitional inquiry that asks what X is and, second, predicative argument that seeks to establish that X is F rather than G.

It is necessary to mention at this point that Socrates occasionally uses or at least refers to a “hypothetical method” that seems modelled on accepted geometrical techniques. While the precise character of this method—possibly exhibited in the Meno and described in the Phaedo—is a matter of continuing scholarly investigation, it is clear that it is a type of predicative argument. For example, when Socrates’ introduces the hypothetical method in the Meno, he does so as a way of determining whether virtue is teachable or not (is X F?) even without knowing what it is. Some commentators deem its introduction to be a pivotal moment in Plato’s philosophical development, whereas others regard it as a diversion from the business of definitional inquiry.

Whatever the precise status of the hypothetical method, Socrates often asserts that the predicative dialogues are incomplete—without an adequate understanding of what X is, one cannot know whether it is F. For example, at the end of the first book of the Republic he maintains that one cannot know whether justice is better than injustice without knowing what justice is; he makes similar remarks at the end of the Meno after the application of the hypothetical method that is alleged to establish attributes without definitions. In this way, Socrates apparently affirms his principle of definitional priority (PD).

On this way of thinking, Socrates’ non-definitional dialogues or sections of dialogue often lead back to definitional discussion. This point is explicitly made at the end of the first book of the Republic, the Meno, and the Protagoras, as the following passage indicates:@

Now, Protagoras, seeing that we have gotten this topsy-turvy and terribly confused, I am most eager to clear it all up, and I would like us, having come this far, to continue until we come through to what virtue is in itself, and then to return to inquire about whether it can or cannot be taught (361c-d; translated by Stanley Lombardo and Karen Bell)

The dialogue concludes in aporia (a state of perplexity), and with an assertion of Socrates’ priority principle. In other words, Socrates suggests that the argument about the properties of virtue has turned on its head and, for this reason, it is necessary to begin an investigation into what virtue is. Once again, the methodological priority of definitional discussion seems to be confirmed.

If the definitional dialogues are epistemically prior to non-definitional dialogues, then the true or archetypical Socratic method must be the one that asks what X is. Predicative discussion is dependent on and, for this reason must return to, definitional inquiry. This result coheres with Aristotle’s testimony in the Metaphysics, where he remarks that Socrates sought the universal in ethics and was the first to be skilled at thinking about definitions (Met. 1.987b and 13.1078b). For these reasons, as well as the fact that predicative argument does not appear to be distinctive as a type of argument, the remainder of this article concentrates on Socrates’ method of definitional inquiry.

6. Evaluating Socrates’ Method

The preceding sections have sought to articulate the nature of the Socratic method. This section discusses its merits. The evaluative question is, of course, not independent of definition—one needs to know what the method is in order to determine its worth and effectiveness. This simple idea is the key insight behind Socrates’ principle of definitional priority.

The following discussion is divided into two parts. In the first, Socrates is taken to be a serious inquirer—as explained earlier, this means that his formal goal aligns with his material goal; he searches for a definition of virtue because he wishes to find one. In the second part, Socrates is assumed to be an ironical inquirer—on this reading, the stance of inquiry is used to pursue ends contrary to learning a definition from an authority.

a. Socrates as Serious Inquirer

The first question of evaluation is whether the formal goal of Socrates’ method is worth pursuing. The answer to this question seems affirmative—attaining knowledge of definitions does appear to be a worthwhile goal; people do want to know the natures of things. However, it is noteworthy that Socrates does not take this to be merely one desirable goal amongst many, for he likely accepts the priority principle (PD)—knowledge of a definition is necessary for knowing anything about virtue. Moreover, some commentators also ascribe to him the view that knowledge of a definition is also sufficient for knowing virtue and perhaps even for being virtuous.

Socrates’ emphasis on knowing definitions seems implausible or at least counterintuitive. An assessment of this position would require an account of how he understands definitional knowing—does this involve having an explicit formula that could be handed on by testimony or, perhaps, the ability to think about virtue correctly? Is it realising the form of virtue in one’s soul—correct psychic organisation? Though these questions are largely beyond the scope of this article, they will be addressed briefly again later in the context of the Socratic fallacy (section 6b).

The second question of evaluation is about means—in short, does Socrates use effective means to his goals? The answer is apparently in the negative as he does not succeed in learning a definition from his interlocutors. This raises further questions, of course—why are the people whom Socrates encounters unable to give a sufficient account? Why does he proceed on the assumption that they can articulate a satisfactory account? It seems strange that he would go around asking the same questions over and over again—the wise man attempting to learn from the ignorant, such as occurs in the Euthyphro and other Platonic writings (see the discussion of the Apology in section 8).

Some commentators argue on these grounds that definitional learning cannot be Socrates’ real goal—it is a pretence designed to facilitate other ends. However, since this response asserts a mismatch between Socrates’ formal and material goals, which is discussed in section 6b.

Another view is that Socrates’ inquiries fail because the priority principle (PD) undercuts the inquiry. Inasmuch as Socrates affirms PD, he asserts that interlocutors cannot know anything about virtue without being able to give a definition. But this means that they cannot use examples and specific judgments about virtue’s qualities to find a satisfactory account. In short, PD prevents them from working towards a definition they do not already possess.

In response, it could be argued that Socrates takes his interlocutors to be authorities—they are not supposed to be searching for an account; they are supposed to verbalise what they know already. Moreover, if the exegetical model is correct, then Socrates does not infer that they do not know but only that they have not articulated their knowledge. On this view, Socrates’ material goals would have to be distinct from his formal goals. There seems to be no other way to explain the indefeasible attribution of knowledge that defines his stance of inquiry (see Section 3).

b. Socrates as Ironical Inquirer

If Socrates’ formal and material goals do not align with one another, then his stance of inquiry is ironical, designed to advance goals contrary to learning a definition from authorities. This raises the question of what these material goals might be, and whether they are desirable and pursued by legitimate means.

The scope of the present article does not permit in-depth discussion of different scholarly interpretations of Socrates’ material goals—some of these were listed above in section 3c. However, most commentators accept that Socrates often refutes his interlocutors’ proposed accounts of virtue. Since this is evidently something that Socrates intends, it must be one of his primary material goals. By focussing on the material goal of refutation, it will be possible to evaluate his method to some extent.

Turning to the question of worth, what is the purpose of Socrates’ refutations and why does he think this goal is desirable? One answer is that refutations generate perplexity or aporia—a sense of not knowing virtue’s nature or, at least, being unable to articulate one’s knowing. Aporia of this type seems to be a valuable state of mind since it is a state of self-awareness. Moreover, and moving up to higher-order goals, aporia can be plausibly connected to virtuous character traits such as open-mindedness and humility. It worth emphasising, in addition, that the material goal of refutation is perfectly compatible with the idea that Socrates uses dialogue to actively shape how his interlocutors think—the examples that come to their minds, what they focus on, ignore, and desire.

Socrates’ method is effective in that he is adept at refuting the definitions that interlocutors propose in answer to the “What is X?” question. However, it might be wondered whether definitional refutation produces genuine aporia, for some interlocutors seem unphased by their inability to answer Socrates and others are actively annoyed rather than chastened and disposed to inquiry. Plato himself raises these anxieties in several dialogues. One cannot forget that Socrates was condemned to death by the Athenians.

Reaching a considered answer to the question of Socrates’ effectiveness in realising his material goals is not straightforward. To do so probably requires attention to complete dialogues in order to track the interlocutors’ psychological development. Moreover, Socrates’ interlocutors are a diverse group—he engages diviners, mathematicians, military generals, tyrants, sophists, children and others. It seems reasonable to say that people do not respond uniformly to his questioning and that some dialogues are more successful than others.

The next question concerns the legitimacy of the means that Socrates uses to pursue his material goals. At a general level, it is clear that the form of his discourse is definitional inquiry and that he argues that specific accounts of virtue are insufficient by showing that they do not conform to principles of definition that interlocutors themselves accept. However, some have thought that while Socrates is effective at refuting his interlocutors, he uses fallacious means.

The term Socratic fallacy was introduced into the literature by Peter Geach. It designates an argument for the claim that someone does not know some example of virtue, or that virtue has a specific quality, on account of her inability to give a definition. More specifically, it maintains that Socrates uses an argument of the following type, and that this is a fallacious line of reasoning:

1. One cannot know that e is an example of X unless one can give a definition of X.
2. Socrates’ interlocutor cannot give a definition of X.
3. Therefore, the interlocutor does not know that e is an example of X.

This argument can be illustrated by substituting ‘obeying the law’ for e and ‘justice’ for X. In short, the interlocutor cannot know that obeying the law is an example of justice if he cannot give a definition of justice.

It is important to notice that the above argument has a valid form; if it is a fallacy, then it must be a fallacy of presumption not inference—akin to false dilemma and not ad hominem, say. This is to say that the source of the Socratic fallacy must be the priority principle (PD) itself. Geach himself takes this view when he says, “We know heaps of things without being able to define the terms in which we express our knowledge”.

Geach’s account of the form of Socrates’ reasoning does not cohere with either the constructive or non-constructive interpretations of his method. The inference that he ascribes to Socrates corresponds more closely with the exegetical model, though it claims that Socrates’ actual reasoning is the reverse of what Geach claims. As noted earlier, Socrates does not infer from the inability to give a definition that the interlocutor does not know that a given example is in fact an example of virtue. He infers from the assumption that the interlocutor does know and the claim that an example is not a definition that he has not articulated his knowledge.

This response does not get to the root of the question of legitimacy, however, since PD might still be false. As just noted, Geach asserts that people can know examples and attributes of things without being able to define them. He seems to be on strong ground in making this claim, for it does seem that one can know, for instance, that obeying the law is just without a definition of justice.

However, Plato’s definitional dialogues suggest that Socrates thinks of the relationship between examples and definitions in a different way. For him, an example is a partial manifestation of a universal—a whole. Thus, to recognise that obedience to the law is an example of justice means knowing justice through one of its parts. And there are other parts as well—for example, telling the truth, returning what is owed, and even disobeying the law on occasion. If this is right, then the interlocutors’ ability to recognise examples shows that they do have knowledge of the whole of which these examples are partial manifestations. One cannot know parts of something unless one in some sense knows the whole of which the parts are parts.

The allegory of the cave that Socrates presents in Plato’s Republic strongly supports this interpretation. When the prisoners recognise the projections on the wall in front of them, for example that this is an X, they recognise a manifestation of an underlying pattern or form. But this means that they do know the whole in a partial way—their mistake is to identify the partial manifestation with the whole, the thing itself. If this is correct, then Socrates’ method of refutation is not evidently fallacious. At worst, it relies on an incorrect account of the relationship between knowledge and belief and the metaphysics of parts and wholes.

7. Socratic Self-Reflections

Socrates practices his method in most Platonic dialogues in which he appears as primary speaker. He describes, theorises, or interprets, the method that he practices less frequently. Two of the most important accounts are his suggestion in the Meno that learning is recollection and his interpretation of teaching as spiritual midwifery in the Theaetetus. This section discusses these self-reflections and their relationship to the analyses of Socrates’ method surveyed earlier.

a. Learning as Recollection in Plato’s Meno

After some unsuccessful attempts at defining virtue, Socrates’ eponymously named interlocutor Meno introduces a paradoxical argument, designed to show that inquiry is impossible. As Socrates reframes it, this argument is as follows:

1. One either knows something or one does not know it.
2. It is impossible to inquire into what one knows, since one already knows it,
3. It is impossible to inquire into what one does not know, for one does not know what one is looking for.
4. Therefore, inquiry is impossible.

Socrates’ reply to Meno’s paradox takes the form of a myth, a story that he claims to have heard from wise men and women. According to this account, the human soul is immortal; because of this, it has seen it all things, both “here” and in Hades, the realm of the unseen. Later, Socrates clarifies that he would not affirm the truth of the myth in every respect—the key point is that people will be better if they believe that they must search for the things they do not know.

The relevance of the myth to Meno’s paradox seems to be that one can inquire into what one knows already. Inquiry is possible if the recollection myth is true, not as the search for “new information” but the reactivation and raising to awareness of what is already known. This type of inquiry and learning is called anamnesis in the Greek—literally, a calling back to mind.

Socrates offers to show Meno that learning is recollection. He does so by posing a mathematical question to an untutored slave—what is the length of the side of a square double in area to that of a two-foot sided square? The slave answers incorrectly at first, but is led to the answer by a series of Socratic questions and diagrams. Although the required length cannot be expressed as a rational number, it can be recognised as the length of the diagonal of the two-foot sided square.

Although the details of the geometry experiment are disputed in the scholarship, it seems clear that Socrates intends to distinguish two modes of learning. The first is testimonial—being told the answer to a question. The second is learning by or grasping reasons or understanding (the word for understanding, manthano, lies at the root of mathematics). With this distinction in mind, it is plain that Socrates does not tell the answer to the slave; instead, he helps him to grasp it by drawing his attention to the relationship between squares and right-angled triangles.

Socrates’ myth of the immortal soul seeks to show that inquiry of a sort is possible—for this reason, one can and should persevere in the attempt to know virtue. When stripped of its mythical garb, Socrates’ claim is that the soul has latent knowledge of virtue—knowledge that is hidden or implicit rather than manifest or explicit. He also seems to assert that this knowledge is innate rather than acquired—it is in the soul for as long as the soul exists; it does not enter when one is born or, for that matter, at any other time. In the end, Socrates’ method of dialogue helps interlocutors to draw up this knowledge and make it active—this is, in essence, what it means to recollect.

b. Spiritual Maieutics in Plato’s Theaetetus

In Plato’s Theaetetus, Socrates describes maieutics, his dialogical practice with a midwife metaphor. Just as physical midwives care for young women during physical pregnancy and childbirth, he cares for young men during spiritual pregnancy and childbirth. Socrates’ method is education in the sense of “guiding out”—this is the meaning of the Latin word educere, from which the word “education” is often thought to be derived.

Socrates’ metaphor of the midwife depends on the concept of spiritual pregnancy, namely the idea that some people have knowledge growing inside their souls like embryos. However, unlike physical pregnancy, it seems common for those who are spiritually pregnant to carry both real and phantom children—Socrates designates the phantoms as wind-eggs. For this reason, an important part of his work is to discriminate between false and true children, to terminate or abort the former and help the latter to a healthy birth.

The metaphor of spiritual pregnancy implies the existence of latent knowledge—that is, again, knowledge that is implicit or unmanifest. It is less clear whether it is innate rather than acquired, for this depends on something that the dialogue does not discuss, namely the existence and identity of the child’s father—the transmitter or perhaps fertiliser of seed. What is evident at least is that Socrates’ spiritual maieutics helps interlocutors transform potential knowledge (knowledge conceived as an embryo) into what is full-fledged and complete (knowledge conceived as a healthy baby).

c. Recollection, Maieutics, and Knowledge

How do the ideas of latent and innate knowledge connect to the models of Socratic dialogue that were presented earlier (see section 3a)? According to the constructive theory, all interlocutors have access to true beliefs that form the premises for the deduction of true and justified conclusions. These propositions are “in” the interlocutor—that is, as beliefs logically entailed by what they consciously entertain. Moreover, Vlastos argues that, while the historical Socrates himself did not investigate the source of these true beliefs, Plato did—in fact, that “wildest of… metaphysical flights, that ultra-speculative theory that all learning is ‘recollection’” (1994, p. 29) is his answer to this question.

According to the non-constructive model, Socrates seeks to examine his interlocutors’ wisdom—he seeks to know whether they have knowledge of virtue. However, since Socrates always concludes that interlocutors do not know because of contradictions in their beliefs, the non-constructive theory does not rely on an account of the role of innate or latent knowledge in shaping the inquiry. Defenders of this account must appeal to another Socratic method to explain the possibility of learning.

According to the exegetical model, Socrates ascribes knowledge of virtue to his interlocutors and, on this basis, infers from apparent errors that they have not given a satisfactory account of what they know. Since this epistemic assumption is indefeasible and adopted prior to the inquiry, Socrates ascribes latent knowledge to the interlocutor. His method thus depends on the distinction between explicitly articulated and latent knowledge of virtue, where the latter is manifested in the ability to give an account.

Socrates’ self-reflections in the Meno and Theaetetus imply that his epistemic assumption, that is, his attribution of knowledge to the interlocutor, is not wholly ironical. Interlocutors are really authorities, since they do in a sense know the answer to the “What is X?” question. The recollection and pregnancy metaphors describe this knowledge in different ways, however: recollection seems to interpret it as formed, needing only to be raised to consciousness (anamnesis), whereas the pregnancy metaphor implies that it is in a state of potentiality.

This difference leads to slightly divergent interpretations of the Socratic method. On the model of teaching as aiding recollection, Socrates’ work is to draw up knowledge that is already articulated. On the model of spiritual maieutics, it is to care for knowledge in potency, an embryo, in order to help it to grow in the proper way. In both cases, however, Socrates searches in order to teach, where this means forming or activating interlocutors’ knowledge. His method is characterised by irony, as his formal and material goals are misaligned.

8. The Apology of Socrates

Plato’s Apology of Socrates is an important source for an account of the Socratic method. This text is not a dialogue but consists of three speeches that purport to be those that Socrates delivered at his trial. This article’s focus is less on the defence against the charges— introducing new gods and corrupting the youth of Athens—than on the account of his method that he gives in the course of his defence.

Socrates explains how he came to live as he has by telling a story of an oracle. According to this story, one of his friends, Chaerephon, went to Delphi to ask the god whether anybody was wiser than him. The priestess replied that no one was—that Socrates was “wisest” or “most wise”. When he learnt of this, he was puzzled, for he was convinced that he was not wise at all, and yet the god could not speak falsely.

After wallowing in perplexity for a long time, Socrates set out to examine the oracle by finding somebody wiser than he was. His intention was to take this person to Delphi and to demand an explanation from the priestess. Socrates carried out his investigation by examining his fellow citizens— he mentions three groups, namely politicians, poets, and artisans. This action did not enable him to find anybody wiser than he was, though it did, significantly, lead him to an interpretation of the oracle’s meaning.

Socrates’ inquiry into the oracle is an exegetical inquiry, for he assumes that the god has knowledge and cannot speak falsely. He uses this epistemic assumption to infer from the apparent untruth of the oracle that the god’s real meaning remains concealed. What Socrates discovers on the basis of this activity is an interpretation of what made him superior to other people, namely his human wisdom. What, then, is human wisdom?

The Apology suggests a hierarchy of epistemic positions: the best condition of a soul is wisdom, which only the gods possess; the worst state is unwitting ignorance, thinking one knows what one does not know—and Socrates stands in the middle. Though he knew nothing truly good or beautiful, he did not believe himself to know such things either. Socrates had a keen sense of his own ignorance and a desire to learn. In short, the god at Delphi approved of Socrates because he was a philosopher—one who loves and pursues wisdom.

Socrates offers several descriptions of his life after interpreting Apollo’s oracle. He says that he has been ordained to live philosophising, examining himself and others—for as long as he can breathe, he will not stop searching for wisdom, and he will exhort his fellow citizens to do the same. Socrates seems to exhort others to be like him: they should not care for money, reputation, and honour, as much as for wisdom (phronesis), truth, and the best possible state of the soul. In short, it seems that Socrates tried to motivate other people to practice philosophy.

Socrates offers a third statement of his mission after his conviction on the formal charges. He now says that the activity of making speeches about virtue and other things, and examining himself and others, is the greatest good for a human being. It is here that he asserts the claim for which he has become famous over the millennia: the unexamined life is not worth living for a human being.

Given these descriptions, how should Socrates’ method be reconstructed? One negative point is he does not mention the search for definitions. However, omission does not imply incompatibility, and the claim that Socrates does not practice a definitional method cannot be right—the priority principle (PD) occupies too central a place in Plato’s writings. Socrates’ failure to mention definition in the Apology is probably to be explained by the forensic context of his speech.

The Apology indicates that Socrates’ method involves the examination of ordinary people and the refutation of pretensions to wisdom. It also has a protreptic dimension—that is, it is designed to encourage interlocutors to pursue wisdom as their highest good. The preeminent value of the examined life for a human being suggests that this life is one of moral learning, of becoming wiser if not becoming wise.

These descriptions map onto the distinction between Socrates’ formal and material goals that was drawn earlier. Though Socrates seeks to learn from anyone and everyone (his formal goal), his conversations are designed to shape souls in a certain way (his higher-order material goal). The material goal of refutation seems especially significant, for it disposes his interlocutors to search and to examine themselves. The Apology does not specify or show how this process cultivates a potential for knowledge.

9. Conclusion

The nature, value, effectiveness, and even existence of the Socratic method is much discussed by scholars. This article has provided a survey of the primary interpretations as well as a framework for thinking about these questions. This concluding section draws together strands from the above discussion to state some tentative conclusions.

First, the Socratic dialogue comes in two basic forms: discussion of the question “What is X?” as opposed to “Is X F?”. The first is the request for a definition of virtue or some related ideal, the second, the attempt to determine whether a given attribute applies to the virtue under discussion—for example, “what is justice?” versus “is justice beneficial?” However, it is clear that Socrates prioritises the first type of dialogue—he suggests that knowledge of the nature of virtue is required for knowledge of its attributes. For this reason, this article concentrates on Socrates’ definitional method.

Secondly, the phrase “Socratic method” is elliptical—a method of what, exactly? Is it a method of inquiry, refutation, or teaching? The answer suggested by the discussion above is that it is all three, though these elements have a different role to play.

In the first place, Socrates presents himself as a searcher after wisdom—he adopts a stance of inquiry, of learning from those who know. However, he responds to proposed answers by introducing principles of definition, what he regards as correct thinking about the subject matter—for example, virtue is a unity, not a multiplicity, and is always good and beautiful. Socrates invites his interlocutors to accept these principles, and they usually do. This (turning now to the second point) invariably leads to the refutation of accounts that they have proposed. Moreover, the application of these principles in the dialogues impels interlocutors to think in a certain way—for example, to generalise from certain paradigms, to make connections between ideas. This is the third point, the formative dimension of Socrates’ method, his psychagogia.

Does the Socratic method proceed by questioning, argument, or some other type of discourse? Again, the answer seems to be all three. The definitional question is evidently primary, and Socrates interrogates answers to this question by asking secondary questions. Yet these questions carry assumptions that enable him to develop arguments against the definitions proposed. Overall, the function of the discussion does not seem to be to learn an account, or to state a position, but to cultivate the interlocutor’s character.

To say that the Socratic method is a dialogue or an inquiry is thus not fully informative—it is not dialogue about house-building or an attempt to learn about bees. It is, more precisely, a method of inquiry into the nature of virtue that is designed to cultivate the virtue it seeks by forming the thought and character of interlocutors. If this is correct, then there is an ironic misalignment between Socrates’ formal and material goals. He uses discourse with the formal goal of learning to do something contrary to learning—the wise man puts himself forward as a student in order to teach.

10. References and Further Reading

a. The Historical Socrates

Boys-Stone, G. and Rowe, C. (eds.) 2013. The Circle of Socrates: Readings in the First-Generation Socratics. Indianapolis: Hackett.
Johnson, D..M. 2021. Xenophon’s Socratic Works. London: Routledge.

b. Plato’s Socrates

Benson, H.H. 2000. Socratic Wisdom: The Model of Knowledge in Plato’s Early Dialogues. New York: Oxford University Press.
Benson, H.H. 2011. ‘Socratic Method’, in D. Morrison (ed.), Cambridge Companion to Socrates, 179–200. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Benson, H.H. 2013. ‘The Priority of Definition’, in J. Bussanich and N.D. Smith (eds.), The Bloomsbury Companion to Socrates, 136–155. London and New York: Continuum.
Brickhouse, T.C., and N.D. Smith. 1994. Plato’s Socrates. New York: Oxford University Press.
Cooper, J.M., and D.S. Hutchinson (eds.). 1997. Plato: Complete Works. Indianapolis/Cambridge: Hackett.
Dancy, R.M. 2004. Plato’s Introduction of Forms. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Forster, M. 2006. ‘Socrates’ Demand for Definitions’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 31: 1–47.
Futter, Dylan B. 2025. Socrates’ Search for Wisdom: An Exegetical Theory. London and New York: Routledge.
Geach, P.T. 1966. ‘Plato’s Euthyphro: An Analysis and Commentary’, Monist 50 (3): 369–382.
Vlastos, G. 1983a. ‘The Socratic Elenchus’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 1: 27–58.
Vlastos, G. 1983b. ‘Afterthoughts on the Socratic Elenchus’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 1: 71–74.
Vlastos, G. 1991. Socrates: Ironist and Moral Philosopher. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Vlastos, G. 1994. ‘The Socratic Elenchus: Method Is All’, in M.F. Burnyeat (ed.), Socratic Studies, 1–29. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Wolfsdorf, D. 2003. ‘Socrates’ Pursuit of Definitions’, Phronesis 48 (4): 271–312.
Zuckert, C.H. 2009. Plato’s Philosophers: The Coherence of the Dialogues. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

Author Information

Dylan Futter
Email: Dylan.Futter@wits.ac.za
University of the Witwatersrand
South Africa

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy