Susan Stebbing (1885—1943)

Susan Stebbing was the first female professor of philosophy in the United Kingdom, a founder of the journal Analysis, and president of the Mind Association and the Aristotelian Society.

One of her most notable academic achievements during that time was developing precise directional analysis, which begins with our common-sense beliefs and breaks them down into their component parts to help better understand what the world would be like if those beliefs were true. Stebbing held that several philosophers in her day employed this type of analysis, but without an appropriately precise system to support its practice. She suggested it as an alternative to the approach of the logical positivists, who began with our basic concepts as a foundation and built on them. Stebbing saw their approach as backward, arguing we should instead start with what we know to be true and break these ideas down.

Stebbing had a wide variety of philosophical concerns beyond analysis and wrote books and articles on several topics. These interests include logic, where she wrote, for example, A Modern Introduction to Logic, the first textbook that took contemporary work in the field seriously. They also include Philosophy of Science, where she published Philosophy and the Physicists, a book intended to show readers that two popular scientists at the time were misusing language and misleading their readership. Her dissertation was on the subject of truth.

Stebbing was also concerned that advances in logic and logical tools were locked away in “the ivory tower”, spending much of her career trying to bring them to the general public. She wrote several books on how to use logic to improve reasoning. One in particular, Thinking to Some Purpose, based on a series of lectures for BBC radio, achieved significant popularity. Stebbing’s work was instrumental in helping non-academic audiences gain access to important academic work and become better reasoners. She was motivated by the need to help people see through biased media and to reason properly about the information they were being given.

What follows presents Stebbing’s work thematically. It starts with her early work and her textbooks, then considers her philosophical work for an academic audience, consisting mostly of contributions to the role of analysis in philosophy. Finally, it examines her work aimed at a general audience, using clear language, and critical thinking in physics and everyday life.

Brief Biography
Bergson and the Pragmatists
Textbooks and The New Logic
Analysis
1. Non-Directional Analysis
2. Directional Analysis
Philosophy of Science and Physics
Critical Thinking
References and Further Reading
1. Further Reading
2. References

1. Brief Biography

Lizzie Susan Stebbing was born in 1885, but she preferred using her middle name “Susan”. Her published names include L.S.S., L.S. Stebbing, L. Susan Stebbing, and Susan Stebbing.

Stebbing was the youngest of six children and was orphaned at an early age. She read for her exams at Girton College, Cambridge, initially in history and eventually in moral sciences. She completed her master’s degree at the University of London in 1912. Stebbing spent most of her career at Bedford College, University of London, where she started as a part-time lecturer in 1915 and ended as the first female professor of philosophy in Britain. She served as president for the Aristotelian Society and the Mind Association, and was one of the founding members of the journal Analysis. She died in 1943 of cancer.

Stebbing faced significant adversity throughout her life. She had Meniere’s disease, which would occasionally cause her to be on bed rest for extended periods. On top of that, being a woman in academia was unusual at this time, so much so that when she became a professor at Bedford, it was newsworthy enough that several papers and periodicals ran articles on her promotion. Siobhan Chapman (2013) comments: “[W]omen were by now an established presence, although certainly a minority one, in academia, but their place there was hard-won and still controversial”. Despite these adversities, Stebbing established herself as a well-respected philosopher.

During her lifetime, Stebbing was best known as the author of A Modern Introduction to Logic, a textbook written for students taking exams and those wanting an introduction to the newest advances in logic. The book includes several diverse chapters, including one on the Aristotelian syllogisms and one on Bertrand Russell’s theory of definite descriptions. Stebbing wrote several other books on logic as well: A Modern Elementary Logic—a condensed and heavily revised version of A Modern Introduction to Logic; Logic in Practice—a text about clear thinking aimed at a general audience; and Thinking to Some Purpose—the book for she is best known today. The aim of Thinking to Some Purpose is to inform the general public about critical and careful thinking. It reads like a how-to guide, starting with common-sense beliefs and teaching the reader how to think critically and carefully about examples in politics, advertising, and the media. Stebbing’s use of real everyday examples from newspapers, advertisements, and the radio was novel at the time.

Stebbing wrote two other books on critical thinking. In Philosophy and the Physicists, she argues that some scientists’ use of everyday language to describe complex phenomena has misled the public. In Ideals and Illusions, she purports to show that reason and careful critical thinking can ameliorate the human condition by “delivering humans from evil and the conditions resulting from it”. She wrote at least forty-nine papers, including “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, where she provides a groundbreaking precisification of the type of analysis typically used by the Cambridge Analysts.

Stebbing was a straightforward, no-nonsense person concerning the work of others, as well as her own. Despite being harsh in her criticisms, she was also quick to praise the success of other philosophers. Highly self-critical, her work contains several references to previous unclarities and she often attempts to re-explain herself. Frederique Janssen-Lauret (2019) argues that Stebbing’s tendency to self-criticize has led some philosophers to dismiss her importance. This is unfortunate, as Stebbing’s work is original and insightful. We should also note that self-criticism embodies her philosophy, resolving ambiguities wherever she sees them.

Stebbing’s abilities were well respected in her time. When G.E. Moore retired from Cambridge, Stebbing was put in competition with Ludwig Wittgenstein as a potential replacement for his chair position. Ultimately, she did not get the job. Wittgenstein was too renowned at the time, and once he applied, no other candidate stood a chance. That she was asked to apply in competition with Wittgenstein speaks to her prominence in the field. This is especially true given the pervasiveness of sexism in philosophy. For example, she recalls a comment by Gilbert Ryle: “Of course everyone thinks you are the right person to succeed Moore, except that you are a woman” (Chapman 2013).

Stebbing published many book reviews. At least eighty have been located thus far, but as Chapman (2013) notes, Stebbing makes mention of several others in her correspondence that have yet to be located. Given the amount of work this requires, she would have had to review a new book every four months of her career on average. Interestingly, Philosophical Studies: Essays in Memory of L. Susan Stebbing, makes no mention of this in the bibliography of her work, suggesting that this particular contribution was overlooked even in her own time.

2. Bergson and the Pragmatists

Stebbing began her academic career as a historian, but when she came across Bradley’s Appearance and Reality, she decided to pursue Moral Philosophy instead (Chapman, 2013). After she completed her history exams, she turned her attention to the exams for Moral Science and completed her graduate work at King’s College London.

Stebbing’s dissertation, Pragmatism and French Voluntarism, focuses on the topic of truth as conceived by the Bergsonian intuitionists and the pragmatists. Roughly, the Bergsonian intuitionists hold that our instincts are more basic than our rational thoughts (this is the reverse of, for example, Descartes). Alternatively, the pragmatists argue that a claim is true only if it is useful and the meaning of a proposition is determined by the consequences of accepting it as true.

Stebbing disagreed with the notion of truth proposed by the Bergsonian intuitionists and pragmatists, claiming both schools failed due to similar, though diametrically opposed, mistakes. According to Stebbing, neither the Bergsonian intuitionalists nor the pragmatists distinguish the nature of truth from how we determine what is true. Stebbing argues one can tell if something is true without a conception of the nature of truth, and, additionally, one can have a conception of the nature of truth without being able to tell if something is true. I can know, for example, that it is true that pigs are mammals without any deep knowledge about the nature of truth. I can also know things about the nature of truth without being able to tell whether any particular proposition is true in the actual world.

In Stebbing’s view, developed in her dissertation, these resulting theories of truth are in opposition. Bergson and the French Voluntarists identify “truth with reality”, and think the only thing that matters is truth’s nature. The pragmatists “identify truth with one of its consequences” and think the only thing that matters is how you determine whether a proposition is true, and hence the consequences of a proposition.

The Bergsonians conclude that we do not need to pursue absolute truth, as it is an affair of the intellect, and the intellect is inadequate for philosophy. The Bergsonians hold that intellect is only capable of analysis and cannot introduce any new ideas onto the scene. New ideas are essential to philosophy, they claim, and so the intellect is not enough for philosophical pursuits.

Stebbing argues that the pragmatists’ conclusion is that truths must be useful. This claim started an argument with F.C.S. Schiller, who accused Stebbing of conflating the slogan “all that works is true” with the slogan “all truths work” (“work” likely means “useful” in this case). Schiller held the former, but not the latter. Stebbing insisted that the pragmatist must hold both.Schiller and Stebbing exchanged papers on the topic in Schiller may have been right in this case. Per Capps (2019), William James was the only pragmatist to relate truth and usefulness in this way, and even then, James defined truth in terms of utility, so it is still controversial to say that he held that a belief is true when it matches reality. It may be that although “all that works is true”, it is not the case that “all truths work”. Usefulness may be a sufficient but not necessary condition for the pragmatists. Although Stebbing may have erred in judging that the pragmatists held such a strong relationship between truth and usefulness, it is still interesting to see her taken seriously by a major contemporary like Schiller.

3. Textbooks and The New Logic

Stebbing wrote A Modern Introduction to Logic as well as a condensed and heavily revised version of the same textbook, A Modern Elementary Logic. Beaney (2017) considers the former to be considered the first textbook on analytic philosophy.

Unlike other textbooks of this time, Stebbing’s are notable in that they cover the traditional logical topics, such as the syllogisms, and also what was being called the “new logic”, in addition to a host of other problems in analytic philosophy. The “new logic”, as discussed by Stebbing, began with Gottlob Frege and was essential to the work of Bertrand Russell and Alfred Whitehead in their Principia Mathematica. Her discussions of the new logic included speculation on where traditional syllogistic logic failed, discussions on relations and classes and definite descriptions, the universal and existential quantifier, variables, and material implication. Both textbooks also dealt with Mill’s methods and the methodology of science in general, which would be categorized today as the philosophy of science. In this sense, they covered much more ground than their precursors.

Both Russell and Whitehead were contemporaries of Stebbing. She often discussed Whitehead’s philosophy of science (see section 5 and Janssen-Lauret (2019)) and was deeply engaged with Russell’s work (for a sample, see her works of 1917; 1931; 1933a; 1934b). Her engagement with both Russell and Whitehead was often quite critical. For example, she objected to logical atomism (1930a, Janssen-Lauret (2017)).

Stebbing also spent time defending the so-called “new logic”, especially from those who took reviews of her textbooks as opportunities to criticize the program. She engaged in a protracted exchange in Mind with H.W.B. Joseph, an Oxford philosopher and defender of Aristotelian logic, over whether the new logic was coherent (Joseph, 1932; Stebbing, 1933b; Joseph, 1933; Stebbing, 1934a; Joseph, 1934). Joseph claimed that Stebbing’s explanation of variables, and hence the use of variables in the new logic, was ill-founded and illegitimate. True to form, Stebbing complained in return that both she and Joseph lacked clarity in their language and were talking past each other.

4. Analysis

Stebbing’s work in metaphysics focused on using analysis in philosophy. Her most famous papers on the topic are “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics” and “Logical Positivism and Analysis”. In these two papers, she argues that directional analysis serves metaphysics better than other forms of analysis and she gives it a precise set of rules.

Stebbing also had interests in and published work on logical constructions, the a priori, and philosophy of language more generally (see, respectively, 1934b, 1933c and 1939a for examples). The breadth of her contributions to metaphysics and analysis is wide. However, the focus in this section is on directional analysis, and the systems of analysis that Stebbing held were not as suitable for metaphysics.

a. Non-Directional Analysis

Stebbing articulates three different types of analysis in “Logical Positivism and Analysis” and one additional one in “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, which she contrasts with directional analysis. We will consider deductive metaphysics and postulational analysis in some detail, and then look briefly at analytic definition of a symbolic expression and analytic clarification of concepts, before articulating the details of directional analysis itself in the next subsection.

Deductive metaphysics engages with the world by starting with the ultimate nature of reality and making conclusions about how the world seems to us from this ultimate nature. Postulational analysis begins by setting up a deductive system, logic, or axioms, and making deductions about apparent reality from there. Both systems approach philosophical activity in the same way. First, they start with a set of basic things or definitions, and then they turn to the world to see how it looks in light of the definitions and/or basic objects. Stebbing claims that both systems go the wrong way—the philosopher must start with the world of common sense, rather than what is ultimate or basic.

“The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, one of Stebbing’s most highly regarded papers of her own time, focuses on deductive metaphysics. A deductive view of metaphysics requires:

(1) That the metaphysician be concerned with Reality;
(2) that Reality have an ultimate, as distinct from an apparent, nature;
(3) that metaphysics give us knowledge of this ultimate Reality.

Stebbing claims that in being concerned with Reality (capital “R”), a deductive metaphysician wishes to provide new facts about Reality rather than looking into the structure of facts we can access through our common-sense investigations. In “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, she claims proper “metaphysics does not consist in creation but investigation”. The claim that good metaphysics would generate a new set of facts about Reality amounts to the claim that there is something “hidden” about the nature of the world, or something we cannot see with common sense. This means metaphysics cannot be deductive. Stebbing puts J.M.E. McTaggart squarely in the deductive metaphysics camp. She asserts that he starts with what is ultimate and then tries to deduce what is apparent from this ultimate.

“Logical Positivism and Analysis”, a paper Stebbing read to the British Academy in 1933, focuses on postulational analysis. Postulational analysis, she argues, “is the kind of analysis used in the construction of a deductive system”. It is the type of analysis that occurs when someone constructs a deductive system, or logic, and tries to use it to analyze the world. One of the aims of postulational analysis is to do the most with the fewest assumptions possible, even when this means the resulting system does not accord at all with common sense. She uses Rudolf Carnap’s Der Logische Aufbau der Welt as an example of this type of pursuit. Carnap starts with specific types of sense data and attempts to derive the world from that data logically. Though this may be an interesting linguistic project, Stebbing claims it is not the appropriate aim of metaphysics. For her, pursuing this type of analysis makes the grave mistake of treating something vague as precise and attempting to fit it into a deductive system.

Stebbing holds that Wittgenstein is doing this type of analysis in the Tractatus. In “Logical Positivism and Analysis”, she claims that Wittgenstein, and the logical positivists generally, employ postulational analysis:

[T]hey suppose that the first problem of philosophy is to determine the principles of symbolism, and from these principles to draw limits with regard to what we can think. This assumption has two important consequences. First, it leads to the view that philosophy is “the activity of finding meaning” . . . The second consequence is that they are apt to place too much reliance upon the construction of postulational systems.

In the same lecture, Stebbing argues that the issue of treating philosophy as the activity of finding meaning arises because (at least as she interprets Schlick), “the pursuit of meaning precedes the determination of the truth or falsity of a proposition”. For Stebbing, though, this simply gets things backwards:

Understanding more or less unclearly what we say, we nevertheless may know that what we say is true. We then inquire what must be the case if what we have said is true. In this way, we come to see more clearly what we were knowing.

We start with some level of understanding of the meaning of what we have said and knowledge of its truth. We then proceed to learn more about it, and, presumably, understand it better.

The second of these issues, an over-reliance on postulational analysis, leads Wittgenstein and the positivists to misapply a truth about a word to the object itself. For example, Stebbing claims that the positivists “regard tables . . . as constructs of the given”. Stebbing insists that it is correct to say that “tables are logical constructions”, but that it is a mistake to think that this statement is about what “table” refers to, rather than the word “table” itself: “[W]e are saying something about the way in which the word ‘table’ may be used in ordinary sentences; we are not saying that what the word ‘table’ refers to is itself a construct”. The tendency of Wittgenstein and the logical positivists to place too much reliance on postulational systems makes them likely to make this mistake because they take the postulational system as basic, rather than the tables themselves. Thus, it is a bad tendency.

Deductive metaphysics and postulational analysis commit the same error, according to Stebbing. They first create a system or set of definitions or the ultimate set of things and then turn to the world to apply their system. They both start with a definition and then seek out things in the world that meet that definition, rather than starting with what we already know and then seeking out what the components of those facts have in common.

Stebbing provides examples, such as “Everyone on the committee is a professor” (see A Modern Introduction to Logic) when discussing directional analysis. There are two candidates for a postulational or deductive analysis of this sentence.

The first is to start by looking for definitions of complex phenomena. So, one way a deductive or postulational analyst might go is to start by looking for the basic building blocks, and their composition relations. Assume, for example, that the basic building blocks are atoms, and their composition relations are chemical bonds. We would then have to piece together the people on the committee out of these atoms and chemical bonds, eventually perhaps adding something basic for their minds. Once we have the people, we can only then go on to think about the committee and the nature of what it is to be a professor (which will assuredly require other complex concepts that we will have to break down, like university).

The second candidate for analysis is purely logical, something like (where C is “on the committee” and P is “professor”):

∀x(Cx → Px)

Though this type of analysis teaches us about the structure of the sentence, it does not help us see more clearly why or how it might be true. This is especially the case since there is no hidden structure, like the hidden structure in Russell’s definition of definite descriptions. For Stebbing, this type of analysis is not focused enough on showing us what the world would be like if our sentence were true. She does hold that there is a time and place for such analyses, but that these types of analyses are not the main goal of metaphysics.

Stebbing also considers what she calls “analytic definition of a symbolic expression” and “analytic clarification of concept” in “Logical Positivism and Analysis”. Stebbing defines the former for sentences:

“E’ is an analysis of E” is to be defined as follows: (i) E’ says what E says; (ii) if ‘a’ is a symbol occurring in E, then what ‘a’ refers to is not less distinctly referred to in E’, and there is some symbol “b” occurring in E’ but not occurring in E.

So, E’ is an analysis of E when it says the same thing as E, refers at least as distinctly to the same things as E and contains at least one symbol that E does not.

As an example of this type of analysis, Stebbing uses Russell’s analysis of definite descriptions. Russell (and Stebbing) analyzes the proposition “The author of Waverly is Scotch,” but we may as well use “The author of Thinking to Some Purpose is a woman”. Russell provides an analysis whereby “the author of Thinking to Some Purpose” is interpreted as a definite description, meaning that its referent is required to exist and be unique for propositions containing it to be candidates for truth. So, “the author of Thinking to Some Purpose is a woman”, upon analysis, becomes “there is exactly one author of Thinking to Some Purpose, and that author is a woman”. This new sentence, it is claimed, says the same thing as “the author of Thinking to Some Purpose is a woman”, makes reference to the same things (Thinking to Some Purpose and author), and contains at least one symbol that the original sentence does not (claims about existence, sometimes notated as ).

Analytic definition of a symbolic expression could “clarify our thoughts . . . because in using ‘E’ we may understand more clearly what we were saying when we used ‘E’ ”. In effect, producing an analytic definition of a symbolic expression amounts to producing a definition. It may also be a candidate for the grammatical analysis that Janssen-Lauret (2019) proposes as part of the solution to the paradox of analysis.

Analytic definition of a symbolic expression is a useful tool, but it is not enough to properly accomplish metaphysics, in Stebbing’s sense. Though it can sometimes help us see more clearly what the world would be like if a particular sentence were true, a definition is not always helpful in this way. For Stebbing, we can define terms when we know what they refer to or when we can use them “significantly in combination with other words” (see A Modern Introduction to Logic). But neither of these guarantee that a definition will help us see more clearly what our beliefs imply about the world, especially if we are producing a new and novel definition that does not match anything actual. So, analytic definition of a symbolic expression is not a type of analysis that will suit the purpose of metaphysics.

An analytic definition of “Everyone on the committee is a professor” might try to analyze the term “professor”. This could result in a sentence in the following form: “Everyone on the committee is a teacher of the highest academic rank at a university”. This analysis presumably says the same things and refers to the same things as the original and contains at least one symbol that the original does not (“rank”, for example). We learn something here about the logical or grammatical structure of the sentence.

Analytic clarification of concepts is far less systematic and may not result in a clarification of our thoughts. It “consists in the elimination of the elements supposed to be referred to whenever we use a symbol ‘S’, but which are not such that these elements must be referred to whenever we so use a sentence containing ‘S’ that the sentence says what is true”. Thus, a symbol is an analytic clarification of a concept “S” when it does not refer to the things that S mistakenly refers to but is in all other respects the same as S. She gives as examples of this type of analysis the clarifications of “mass”, “force”, and “simultaneity”. Her main target appears to be those who say something close to the truth but lack a clear understanding of the concept in question. Eric Schliesser argues that analytic clarification of concepts is “the effect of scientific development”. This would mean that analytic clarification of concepts occurs when we must adjust our ordinary beliefs in light of our scientific practices.

Stebbing relies on the example of simultaneity in “Logical Positivism and Analysis”. Prior to Einstein’s discovery that simultaneous events are not really simultaneous in the sense that we had thought, “we thought we knew quite well what was meant by saying ‘happening at the same time in London and New York’”. However, upon Einstein’s discovery, “we did not know quite well what we meant; we now understand that what we thought to be essential is not so”. In effect, we learn that we were systematically mistaken. Analytic clarification of concepts is supposed to rectify these situations.

Again, analytic clarification of concept is not a strong enough tool to completely accomplish the goal of metaphysics. Although this may sometimes help clarify our beliefs, it can also have a distorting effect. Stebbing herself admits it may not always clarify our thoughts. Scientific developments can be complex and do not always help us see things more clearly, at least not without significant work to explain them.

An analytic clarification of concepts for the sentence “Everyone on the committee is a professor” is more complicated, since we do not yet know what we are confused about. Suppose, though, that the committee is open to professors of any rank. It might be that someone could utter the sentence and assume that “professor” meant only “full professor”, and excluded assistant and associate professors. Then, we might analytically clarify the sentence as “everyone on the committee is an assistant, associate, or full professor.” The person uttering the original might still have said something true, despite not quite knowing why they said something true, but now we are in a better position to see the actual extent of what the original sentence means.

b. Directional Analysis

Directional analysis is, very roughly, a form of analysis that starts with our common-sense beliefs and breaks them down into what they are made of . It thus allows us to see more clearly what the world must be like for our beliefs to be true. Stebbing claims that directional analysis is the type of analysis that Moore uses.

In “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, she argues that “the aim of metaphysics is to reveal the structure of that to which reference is made in true statements”. Metaphysics does not reveal new facts about the world but rather teaches us about the structure of such facts. In “Logical Positivism and Analysis”, she maintains that the purpose of analysis is “to enable us to understand something more clearly”. This is a rough restatement of a claims she makes in “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, where she insists that metaphysics needs to investigate:

(i) [W]hat exactly we are believing when we believe that there is a table in this room, that it was here three hours ago, and so on; (ii) how our various beliefs are inter-related;
(iii) how our inconsistent beliefs may be adjusted, and which should be rejected.

Common sense is at the core of her approach to analysis, as expressed by her claim that we learn more about our common-sense beliefs through analysis:

We must begin with common-sense facts, such as I see this candle, or This blow on his head killed this man, or Her remarks made him angry. It is useless first to define “material thing,” or “cause,” and then to ask whether the terms so defined are exemplified in the world. Yet this is what the deductive metaphysician does, unless he takes the easier course of defining the terms, and then ruling out whatever does not conform to the definition as ‘mere appearance’.

To accommodate this intuition, and in response to the failures of the previous approaches, Stebbing attempts to make directional analysis precise. In “Logical Positivism and Analysis”, she claims:

A directional analysis of a sentence ‘S’ consists of a set of steps such that (i) each step results in a sentence (to be called ‘a resultant’) which is such that this sentence reveals more clearly the multiplicity of the fact (expressed both by ‘S’ and by the resultant) so that the resultant shows more clearly the structure of the fact expressed; and (ii) if the analysis were completed, the final resultant would have the same multiplicity as the fact expressed by ‘S’ and by the resultant at each step. Thus the final resultant would reveal the form, the elements, and the mode of their combination.

The multiplicity of a fact is a function of the number of components involved and the relationships between them. A directional analysis of a sentence more clearly demonstrates what the world is like if that sentence is true, and, if completed, results in a perfect picture of the facts involved in making the sentence true. It shows us how its precise elements are put together, and what its truthmakers must be.

Directional analysis can do things that the three other types of analysis Stebbing presents cannot. Stebbing expresses this clearly in “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”:

We understand more or less clearly. In the endeavour to understand more clearly we use words and sentences, and then reflect upon how we are using them, and whether we are so using them as to say what is true, or what might have been true although it happens to be false. Such reflection is required in the case of directional analysis.

Directional analysis, then, can show us what the world would be like if our beliefs were true, whereas the other types of analysis cannot (or at least do not have this as their primary purpose). It does not make the same mistakes that she accuses postulational analysis of making. Directional analysis starts with the goal of analyzing our common-sense beliefs. It has the right aim for metaphysics and does not do things backwards.

Turning to more details of the system, in “Substances, Events and Facts”, Stebbing claims that there are two presuppositions that the analysis of facts rests on:

(1) [T]hat some propositions can be known to be true; (2) that directional analysis is possible.

Here, we see the initial ideas that support Stebbing’s further discussions of directional analysis. We must be able to know that some propositions are true, and it must be the case that directional analysis is possible. These presuppositions play a major role in her most sustained articulation of directional analysis, “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”.

In “Substances, Events and Facts” she provides further details about what it takes for an analysis to be directional:

To say that the analysis of F is directional is to say that if F be analysed into a, b, c, then a, b, c, are on a lower level than F; and if a be analysed into a₁, a₂, then a₁, a₂ are on a lower level than a. The relation being on a lower level than is clearly asymmetrical and transitive. To say that a is on a lower level than F is to say that a is in some sense simpler than F.

This is one of Stebbing’s first definitions of directional analysis in print. We can see her emphasis on simplicity. We move from more complex facts to simpler ones, which allows us to learn “the structure of that to which reference is made in true statements”.

In “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, Stebbing defines a level as “a Resultant in which every factor [configured element] has been carried to the same degree of analysis”. A Resultant (R) is any completed step in an analysis procedure, and is of higher order than another (R’) when it contains “configured elements, some of which are either replaced by unconfigured elements in the next step or are replaced by unconfigured elements in a fewer number of steps from R’ than is required to replace any configured element in R

A configuration of elements is a fact, for Stebbing, and some facts may contain other configurations as elements. In other words, some facts may have subfacts. Simple facts are configurations, which contain no configured elements. If a fact contains a configured element, it is more complex than the configuration it contains. Thus, for Stebbing, a fact is of lower level than another when it contains fewer subfacts as elements. Stebbing gives an example of the difference between same-level analysis and lower-level analysis in “Directional Analysis and Basic Facts”. She holds that one same-level analysis of “A and B are first cousins” is “One parent of A is a brother or a sister of one parent of B” because it is definition-like. Further, she holds that ordinary scientific definitions, and an analysis of “Every economist is fallible” as “Something is both an economist and fallible and it is not the case that something is an economist and not fallible”, are same-level analyses. On the other hand, an analysis of a sentence about a committee into a sentence about individuals is directional. If we further analyze a sentence about an individual into a sentence about “bodily and mental states”, then we again have a directional analysis. This marks the difference in level, for Stebbing. Sentences analyzed at the same level make reference to exactly the same things as in the original sentence, but a directional analysis does not. For Stebbing, “the direction is from higher-level non-basic facts to lower-level non-basic facts, and finally to basic facts”.

In “Some Puzzles about Analysis”, Stebbing claims that John Wisdom’s distinction between same-level and new-level analysis is the same as her distinction between same-level and directional analysis. She reiterates this claim in her contribution to Moore’s Schilpp volume:

Mr. John Wisdom . . . at one time laid great stress upon what I call directional analysis, which he re-named ‘new level analysis’. His proposal [is] to analyse ‘nation-sentences’ (e.g., ‘Germany hates Russia’) into ‘individual sentences’ (e.g., ‘Fritz hates Ivan’), and these again into sense-data sentences.

Stebbing disagrees that sense-data sentences mark the end point of directional analysis, since they are the result of a process of abstraction, and thus not basic facts. But she does seem to approve Wisdom’s new-level proposal to analyze “nation” into “individual” (Wisdom, 1934). At the most basic level, for Stebbing, we have basic facts, or “absolutely specific facts” (see “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”). Rather than sense-data, she suggests absolutely specific facts might be about absolutely specific shades of color, tastes, or sounds, though she is far from committed to exactly what they are. She later repudiates basic facts, so this is not surprising.

A step in an analysis of a sentence is of a lower level than the original when it is simpler, in the sense that it contains fewer configured elements. In more colloquial terms, this means it breaks things down into its component parts.

A directional analysis of “Everyone on the committee is a professor” is accordingly quite different from the other types of analysis, such as a candidate analysis (Person 1 is a professor, and Person 2 is a professor), where “Person n” is the name of the n^th committee member. In this way we reduce the complexity of the components involved in the original statement by eliminating one concept and replacing it with less complex ones. We have eliminated “committee” in favor of the people involved, thereby reducing the proposition originally about a committee to the members of that committee. This, then, may serve as the first step in a directional analysis. We can go further here, too. Following this analysis, we could proceed with another step: “These bodily and mental states make up a professor, these other bodily and mental states make up a professor . . .” As shown, directional analysis separates complex ideas into their simpler constituent parts.

A directional analysis of “Everyone on the committee is a professor” is accordingly quite different from the other types of analysis. A candidate analysis is:

Person 1 is a professor, and Person 2 is a professor, and…

where “Person n” is the name of the n^th committee member. In this way, we reduce the complexity of the components involved in the original statement, by eliminating one concept from it and replacing it with less complex ones. We have eliminated
“committee” in favor of the people involved, thereby reducing the proposition originally about a committee to the members of that committee. This, then, may serve as the first step in a directional analysis. We can go further here, too. The next step in this analysis might be something like:

These bodily and mental states make up a professor, these other bodily and mental states make up a professor…

Very roughly, directional analyses break things down into what they are made of. One might wonder whether Stebbing is just renaming Russell’s logical atomism. In fact, there is good reason to think that she repudiated atomism, as she discusses several objections to the position over the course of her career (see Janssen-Lauret, 2017, for more details).

One might wonder whether Stebbing is just renaming Russell’s logical atomism. In fact, there is good reason to think that she repudiated atomism, as she discussed several objections to the position over the course of her career.

In her pursuit of providing a more formal set of rules for directional analysis, Stebbing defines a “fact” and some surrounding concepts in “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”. For Stebbing, a fact is “a configuration of elements”. She takes this to be equivalent to Wittgenstein’s claim that a fact is “a set of elements arranged in a certain way.” Facts (or configurations) may be elements in other configurations. A configuration containing no other configurations is a basic fact (or, as above, a fact with no subfacts is a basic fact). A resultant (little “r”) is the final step in an analysis of a fact, and a Resultant (capital “R”) is any completed step in the analysis. One Resultant is of higher order than another when it contains more configured elements.

Directional analysis rests on presuppositions, which Stebbing formulates as follows:

(a) The logical presupposition:

If p is to be analyzed, then p must be understood. It follows that there is at least one expression, which unambiguously expresses p.

(b) The metaphysical presuppositions:

1. If p is to be analyzed, then it is not always the case that p is known to be false, and it is sometimes the case that p is known to be true.

Directional analysis is possible.
1. 1. There is a way of analyzing p such that we can correctly speak of the analysis of p.
    This assumption is equivalent to the assertion that we must be able to say, “There is one and only one analysis of p, and this is that analysis.”
1. 1. If π₁,π₂…,π_n, is the analysis of p, then p entails and is entailed by π₁,π₂…,π_n.
    It follows that there is no sub-set out of π₁,π₂…,π_n which is the analysis of p.
1. Each Resultant of higher order contains more configured elements than the Resultant of the next step.
  1. The lowest level Resultant is the resultant of the analysis.
Every Resultant refers to a set of basic facts.
Each factor in a given level must exclude every other factor in that level.
A basic fact is an absolutely specific fact.

The logical presupposition implies that we need to understand (on an immediate level) what we analyze. The metaphysical presuppositions are more complicated. Assumption 2, Stebbing claims, is equivalent to the assertion that some propositions are known to be true. Though directional analysis is still possible if p is false, it cannot be the case that all propositions are known to be false:

[W]e often do not know what we assert is true or false, and sometimes we are led to reject a possible view because the directional analysis of a proposition shows that something would have to be the case which we believe not to be the case.

All that is meant by assumption 2 is the anti-skeptical claim that some propositions are true.

The presuppositions under 3, Stebbing continues, follow from the assumption that directional analysis is possible. 3.1 guarantees that we have a single analysis of a proposition, whereas 3.2 guarantees that the original proposition and its analysis entail each other. Further, 3.5 guarantees that our resultant is indeed simpler than the original proposition.

An analysis terminates in basic facts, and hence the resultant always exists, as demonstrated by the presupposition, “Each Resultant of higher order contains more configured elements than the Resultant of the next step” (3.3), which guarantees that each step in a directional analysis is simpler than the one before. Given that Stebbing (at this point) holds that there are basic facts, presupposition 3.4 requires that each analysis terminates with basic facts. 3.6 describes the nature of basic facts so that they must be absolutely specific. Stebbing asserts that the assumption “absolutely specific elements (basic facts)” exist is “plausible”, and that she sees “no reasons against it”.

The existence of basic facts is contentious. Both Eugene Bronstein (1933) and Max Black (1933) wrote sustained criticisms of Stebbing’s use of basic facts in directional analysis. Both also suggested that directional analysis was not possible due to this use.

Bronstein identifies three problems for directional analysis based on “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics” and “Logical Positivism and Analysis”. He claims that directional analysis is used to infer the existence of basic facts and that this inference is risky.

Bronstein’s arguments against basic facts amount to more of an assertion of their controversy. He states:

[W]hen [directional analysis] ends, and it does end, it ends in basic facts; directional analysis becomes the deus ex machina, introduced to save basic facts.

Basic facts are dubious, per Bronstein. Since Stebbing argues that directional analysis is possible and terminates at basic facts, he holds that directional analysis is being used to prove the existence of something dubious. Stebbing insists he has things backward. What she argued is not that the possibility of directional analysis proves that basic facts exist, but that directional analysis is possible only if they do. Furthermore, she agrees that the existence of basic facts is dubious.

Black makes a much more sustained argument in favor of what he calls “logical analysis” as opposed to directional analysis. We will focus only on his concerns about basic facts in directional analysis. He claims, essentially, that we can never know whether there are such things as basic facts, and so we can never know whether directional analysis is indeed possible. He claims:

It can never be known that there are simple elements [basic facts], and hence, if [Stebbing] is right in her view of analysis, it can never be known whether metaphysical analysis is possible.

Stebbing’s response to both Bronstein and Black seems to be the same—she concedes that basic facts may not exist, making directional analysis potentially impossible.

This may represent a change of opinion for Stebbing. In “Substances, Events and Facts”, which appears just before “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”, Stebbing indicates that there are “at least five assumptions commonly made by those who employ analysis in metaphysics” but that “they are all disputable”. She adds that she “should be ready to grant them all” herself. In saying this, she points to her forthcoming “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics”. Importantly, Stebbing maintains that she would be ready and willing to grant that the assumptions of directional analysis are true.

However, in “Directional Analysis and Basic Facts”, she claims that there may not be basic facts, or at least, they may not be epistemically accessible to us. She further claims that “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics” was not an argument for directional analysis, but rather an exercise in pointing out what the presuppositions of such a system might be. In “Directional Analysis and Basic Facts”, she claims that:

[T]he method of analysis as practiced by philosophers required the assumption that the analysis terminate in basic facts, and that this assumption was not ‘certainly justified’ and was not ‘even very plausible’.

Still, she insists in “The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics” that she sees no reasons against postulating basic facts (“the assumption is plausible”). This seems to contradict her claims in the same paper that the presuppositions of directional analysis are “far from being certainly justified, and not even very plausible”. It may be, then, that earlier she hoped basic facts might be shown to exist, but later lost hope.

5. Philosophy of Science and Physics

Toward the beginning of her career, Stebbing focused on the philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead. She had a great respect for Whitehead, but this did not stop her from being critical. In her review of his work Process and Reality, she complains about his use of misleading language. This included his two definitions of God as “creativity” and as “infinitely patient”.

Elsewhere, she focuses on Whitehead’s notion of “perceptual object”. Whitehead contends that perceptual objects are based directly on common-sense things. Stebbing, on the other hand, claims that a proper explanation of them merely starts with common-sense things. In “Professor Whitehead’s “Perceptual Object””, Stebbing notes that Whitehead identifies perceptual objects with “so little qualification and that it can scarcely be denied that the common-sense ‘table’ is much too crude to be a perceptual object”. Moreover, as Stebbing goes on to say, Whitehead’s assertion that perceptual objects are common-sense things is misleading, since common-sense things are “a product of sense-awareness and unrecognized metaphysical prejudices that have no secure basis in fact”, while perceptual objects are “what remains when the prejudices and inconsistencies have been cleared away”. This is in part because Whitehead settles on a rather non-common-sense notion of what a perceptual object is: it is an adjective. Stebbing argues that this idea is contrary to the common-sense understanding of perceptual objects: “The notion that a perceptual object, a chair, is an adjective is certainly shocking to common sense and to many philosophers”. Janssen-Lauret (2022) provides more details on Stebbing’s philosophical interactions with Whitehead. Stebbing’s work on Whitehead and analysis had a direct relationship to her work in the philosophy of physics. In her first symposium paper on the subject, she argues that once we clarify what “materialism” and “idealism” mean, we can use older work of Whitehead’s to see that the new physics (the term she used for post-Einsteinian work in physics) does not require idealism to be true.

In other work on similar topics, she argues that McTaggart’s discussions of time are ambiguous because he is not precise enough about what the question, “Is time real?” is asking (see “Some Ambiguities in Discussions Concerning Time”). She also criticizes Sir James Jeans for misleading his readership by using language inappropriately (see “Physics, Materialism and Free Will” and “The New Physics and Modern Materialism”). Generally, she argues against the lack of precise language use in physics and philosophy of physics.

Her main contribution to this field is Philosophy and the Physicists. This book is written for a general audience and takes issue with the philosophies that Jeans and Sir Arthur Eddington propose in their books on physics aimed at general audiences. She accuses Jeans and Eddington of making a grave error in their presentation of physics by trying to argue that “modern physics shows the world to be a very different sort of place than it indeed seems to be” (Willow, 1995, p 127). She thinks that they use inappropriate language to communicate their material to the general reader, and thus prevent them from arriving at the truth and adjusting their thinking to accommodate it. Stebbing holds that “careful use of reason and knowledge” (Willow, 1995, p 127) would otherwise enable this adjustment in thought. Stebbing alleges that their use of language, particularly that of Eddington, deliberately misled their audience into thinking that the world was other than what it was. For example, the claim “the plank is not really solid” is one of the claims Stebbing found misleading, as discussed in Philosophy and the Physicists. We know via common sense that the plank is really solid, for solid could not mean anything other than what the plank is. Stebbing held that new language was needed to describe to a common audience what was meant here, rather than using everyday language and confusing the reader and leading them to doubt their common-sense beliefs without good reason. Stebbing herself is explicit about the relationship between the language of common sense and science:

No concepts drawn from the level of common-sense thinking are appropriate to sub-atomic, i.e. microphysical, phenomena. Consequently, the language of common sense is not appropriate to the description of such phenomena.

Common-sense language and concepts are inappropriate for some complex scientific investigations. The colloquial meaning of “solid” as something “firm” needs to be redefined as a scientific concept, such as “non-porous at the microscopic level”.

Eddington offers an example in The Nature of the Physical World:

I am standing on the threshold about to enter a room. It is a complicated business. In the first place I must shove against an atmosphere pressing with a force of fourteen pounds on every square inch of my body. I must make sure of landing on a plank traveling at twenty miles a second around the sun—a fraction of a second too early or too late, the plank would be miles away . . . The plank has no solidity of substance. To step on it is like stepping on a swarm of flies. Shall I not slip through?

Eddington is essentially suggesting that there are two worlds—that of common sense and that of the scientist. Stebbing disagrees with his reasoning in Philosophy and the Physicists:

The danger arises when the scientist uses the picture for the purpose of making explicit denials, and expresses these denials in common-sense language used in such a way as to be devoid of sense. This, unfortunately, is exactly what Eddington has done in the passage we are considering, and indeed, in many other passages as well.

Stebbing is convinced that Eddington is wrong here, in part because he is using the “language of common sense” to describe a micro-physical phenomenon. By continuing to pretend “solid” still means “firm”, Stebbing held that this use of language did not help the audience learn anything, adding in “Nebulous Philosophy” that “unfortunately, the popularizing scientist too often delights rather to mystify the reader rather than enlighten him”.

More broadly, Stebbing seems to be insisting that since physicists are not trained philosophers, they should not be doing philosophy. Both Jeans and Eddington make grandiose claims about what the world must be like for the new physics to be true: that there is a god, but he is a mathematician, that free will cannot exist, that the world consists only of pointer readings (the recordings of measurements by devices), et cetera. They fail to see, Stebbing argues, how these claims conflict with common sense and do so without reason. Stebbing holds that this overreaching was a result of a lack of critical thinking about their own subject and the relation of that subject to things beyond it. Had they been more precise in their language and clearer in their explanations, they would have seen for themselves that physics is not metaphysics and that their philosophical conclusions went well beyond their evidence.

6. Critical Thinking

Stebbing’s emphasis on clear and precise language and thinking went beyond her academic work. Much of her career was devoted to what is known today as public philosophy. She was concerned with two issues: the first was to point out common mistakes in everyday thinking, and the second was to offer insights into how to avoid them in the future. To address these issues, Stebbing adopts a dual role as critic and teacher, and this dual role influences her popular writings about critical thinking. She seemed incredibly optimistic about the potential effects of teaching people to think critically. In Ideals and Illusions and Men and Moral Principles, she suggests that the current political situation (mostly with respect to WWII) might have been less extreme if politicians and the media had not misled people or if they had had the tools to think through what was being said to them.

Thinking to Some Purpose is Stebbing’s best-known and best-received work on this subject (see Chapman 2013). Although there were several books on critical thinking and language intended for the general public on the market, hers was notable in that almost all of her examples came from sources that people would have had regular access to, such as political speeches, advertising campaigns, and newspaper articles.

A particularly striking example of this occurs when she compares several news outlets’ coverage of a contemporary event, as when Lord Cecil requested that the government whip not be sent to him (essentially meaning that he would no longer vote along party lines). Over the course of almost two full pages (p 226-228), she lists the length and content of newspaper coverage of the letter Cecil sent announcing his decision. The coverage is wildly variable and depends on the political point of view of the newspaper. The coverage runs from fully re-printing the letter to a complete lack of reporting on the event. This example of the wide variety of coverage on the same event was one of many examples of the misleading use of language and space pointed to by Stebbing, in this particular case about the omission of what might be thought of as important information. For Stebbing, this use is egregious, as she held that newspapers are considered by many to be a source of information only and not to take stands on issues:

[Omissions] can be detected only if we form the habit of consulting newspapers representing different political views. That this should be necessary is deplorable. We are considering not views, but news.

This provides all the more reason to train ourselves to think clearly and critically about everyday affairs. Achieving different perspectives on the same topic can be the goal of an ideal reasoner, but this is not possible if the presentation of the topic aims to persuade us of something rather than to convince us of its truth through reasoned argument. Finding different perspectives on the same topic is only one method to help distinguish between what we know to be true and what we merely believe to be true, or what we take for granted as probably based on common sense.

Stebbing emphasizes early on that logical thinking is desirable, and that “to think logically is to think relevantly to the purpose that initiated the thinking; all effective thinking is directed to an end”. Further, logic helps us think clearly. Here, logic does not only encompass formal systems like syllogisms or work being done by her contemporaries on the new logic. Logic, in the sense Stebbing is using it, is more than an attempt to derive a priori knowledge from some set of axioms (which is in keeping with her views on metaphysics that our philosophical aims are not to find indubitable truths). Logic encompasses more than formal systems, notably what we would call critical thinking today.

For Stebbing, the best thinking is done when trying to solve a problem. Problems can be simple, like “What should I eat for lunch?” or “What did my dad say to me last night?” They can also be more complex, like “How do we find world peace?” However, there are additional complications to thinking clearly about a purpose. Our character traits, for example, sometimes prevent us from recognizing the truth by blinding us to certain evidence, or making us focus on unnecessary information. This may lead to concealed contradictions in our thinking. One way we can help someone think more clearly is by pointing out concealed contradictions in their thinking.

As always, determining what a concealed contradiction is, and what we know to be true versus what we merely believe to be true, is a challenge. As Stebbing says, we all have beliefs that are “cherished”. They are sometimes the things our parents believed, so we grew up believing them too, or sometimes the things associated with our chosen political party, or other things altogether. These types of prejudices can also come from an inability to see another person’s perspective. To have an accurate picture of the world, we need to try to see it from other people’s perspectives. For Stebbing, thinking clearly means questioning these beliefs. There is a danger, she holds, in not questioning these beliefs, not making their assumptions clear, and forgetting that we ourselves are prejudiced:

I do seek to convince the reader that it is of great importance that we ordinary men and women should think clearly, that there are many obstacles to thinking clearly, and that some of these obstacles can be overcome provided that we wish to overcome them and are willing to make an effort to do so.

We must put in the effort to overcome our prejudices if we want to be clear thinkers.

Language use plays an essential role in both clear thinking and problematic thinking. As Chapman (2013) points out, Stebbing acknowledges that during her career, she was largely concerned with how to make language clear and coherent. In the domain of critical thinking and logic, Stebbing was worried that poor use of language would impede clear thinking. Well-chosen words can communicate a fact or proposition best, but they can also trick listeners into believing something that may or may not be true if chosen poorly. Sometimes language is used to “induce . . . readers to agree [to a claim] . . . rather than to convince them that . . . it is sound”. We should use language to help readers see that a claim is sound and to help them think clearly about it. Poorly chosen language “makes for twisted thinking”, since it can mislead us into thinking we have good reasons for a belief when we do not.

“Potted thinking” is a term Stebbing uses for thinking that is too quick: “[P]otted thinking is easily accepted, is concentrated in form, and has lost the vitamins essential to mental nourishment”. Potted thinking is easy thinking. It occurs when we accept slogans as facts rather than quips, when we do not think through complicated things because it is too time-consuming. The term is a reference to potted meat, which is “a vacuum-packed product such as Spam that you might find in a wartime ration pack” (West, 2012), and although it can sustain you, it is not as healthy as regular meat and has lost many of its valuable nutrients. Potted thinking, though, is not always bad. Sometimes it is a necessary shortcut, and some of our unproblematic common-sense beliefs even seem to fit the bill (like “many hands make light work”). Stebbing claims we need to review our thinking about what led us to our potted belief from time to time. This occasional review will save us time, and keep us from the worst of potted thinking.

Other features of critical thinking that also broach this helpful/harmful divide, according to Stebbing, include metaphors and analogies. Sometimes metaphors and analogies can help make a difficult topic easier to understand, but if we accept them too easily and without thinking them through, they can be problematic and misleading. For this reason, Stebbing claims that analogies can be used to suggest conclusions but not to establish them.

There are a host of other influences that can twist our thinking, Stebbing says. She addresses propaganda, persuasion, misleading uses of statistics, and fallacious reasoning. Because we can be misled in all these ways, Stebbing argues that we must recognize that sometimes our beliefs need to be tested:

My thinking is twisted when I believe that I am thinking effectively and have discovered sound reasons for my conclusion but am mistaken in this belief.

The lack of clarity of my belief may cause me to think that it is well-justified when it is not. There can be many reasons our thinking is twisted. Sometimes, twisted thinking is benign: we may simply not have access to all the needed information. But sometimes it is not. Our thinking may be potted or mistaken. More problematically, people sometimes make crooked arguments. That is, they sometimes make arguments to persuade you that something is true while knowing full well they have not given you enough information to think clearly about the topic. To avoid this, we must regularly test our beliefs, just as scientists test their hypotheses.

Stebbing may have been overly optimistic in her hopes for what clear thinking could achieve. At times, it sounds like she convinced herself that if we were all clear thinking and careful language users, WWII would never have occurred. Though clear and careful thinking and language use might indeed improve our situations, her hope that they could fix them completely is perhaps overly ambitious. She has a particularly apt quote about the current political situation at the end of Thinking to Some Purpose:

Amidst the ruins [of the current state of the world] it is still possible to preach the ideal of freedom, truth, happiness and love. The choice offered us is evil, but it is not necessary to choose the worse. The way before us is hard, but it is not impossible to make it lead towards a world where men can be free and happy because they are not afraid of the truth, however uncomforting, and have learnt that love casts out fear and brings peace.

If we are careful thinkers, we can be freer people. We must learn to accept the truths that we discover through careful thinking, even though that may be challenging to do. In this sense, Stebbing thought that despite its difficulty, training ourselves to be careful and precise everyday thinkers would ultimately help us make the world a better place.

7. References and Further Reading

Parts of this article are based on an English translation of (Kouri Kissel 2019).

a. Further Reading

b. References

Aristotelian Society for the Systematic Study of Philosophy (1948). Philosophical Studies: Essays in Memory of L Susan Stebbing. London: George Allen and Unwin Ltd.
Beaney, M. (2017). Analytic Philosophy: A Very Short Introduction. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Black, M. (1933). Philosophical Analysis. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 33, 237–258.
Bronstein, E. D. (1933). Miss Stebbing’s Directional Analysis and Basic Facts. Analysis 2 (1-2), 10–14.
Capps, J. (2019). The Pragmatic Theory of Truth. In E. N. Zalta (Ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2019 ed.). Metaphysics Research Lab, Stanford University.
Chapman, S. (2013). Susan Stebbing and the Language of Common Sense. New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
Eddington, A. S. (1928). The Nature of the Physical World. London: Dent.
Janssen-Lauret, F. (2017). Susan Stebbing, Incomplete Symbols and Foundherentist Meta-Ontology. Journal for the History of Analytical Philosophy 5 (2), 7–17.
Janssen-Lauret, F. (2019). Susan Stebbing’s Metaphysics and the Status of Common Sense Truths. In J. Peijnenburg and S. Verhaegh (Eds.), Women in the History of Analytic Philosophy, pp. 171–195. Cham: Springer Nature.
Janssen-Lauret, F. (2022). Susan Stebbing. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Joseph, H. (1932). A Defence of Freethinking in Logistics. Mind 41 (164), 424–440.
Joseph, H. (1933). A Defence of Free-Thinking in Logistics Resumed. Mind 42 (168), 417–443.
Joseph, H. (1934). A Last Plea for Free-Thinking in Logistics. Mind 43 (171), 315–320.
Kouri Kissel, T. (2019). Susan Stebbing. Portale Italiano di Filosofia Analytica 19, 34 pp. Accessed: 2024-07-22.
Schliesser, E. (2023). Stebbing on Clarity. Https://philarchive.org/rec/SCHSOC-13.
Stebbing, L. S. (1914). Pragmatism and French Voluntarism: With Especial Reference to the Notion of Truth in the Development of French Philosophy From Maine de Biran to Professor Bergson, Volume 6. Girton College Studies.
Stebbing, L. S. (1917). Relation and Coherence. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 17, 459–480.
Stebbing, L. S. (1924). Mind and Nature in Prof. Whitehead’s Philosophy. Mind 33 (131), 289–303.
Stebbing, L. S. (1925). Universals and Professor Whitehead’s Theory of Objects. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 25, 305–330.
Stebbing, L. S. (1926). Professor Whitehead’s “perceptual object”. Journal of Philosophy 23 (8), 197–213.
Stebbing, L. S. (1928). Symposium: Materialism in the Light of Modern Scientific Thought. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes 8, 113–119.
Stebbing, L. S. (1930a). A Modern Introduction to Logic. London: Methuen.
Stebbing, L. S. (1930b). Review of “Process and Reality: An Essay in Cosmology” by A.N. Whitehead. Mind XXXIX(156), 466–475.
Stebbing, L. S. (1931). Logical Constructions and Knowledge Through Description. In Proceedings of the Seventh International Congress of Philosophy, pp. 117–121.
Stebbing, L. S. (1932a). Substances, Events, and Facts. Journal of Philosophy 29 (12), 309–322.
Stebbing, L. S. (1932b). The Method of Analysis in Metaphysics. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 33, 65–94.
Stebbing, L. S. (1933a). Logical Positivism and Analysis. Annual Philosophical Lecture Henriette Hertz Trust.
Stebbing, L. S. (1933b). Mr. Joseph’s Defence of Free Thinking in Logistics. Mind 42 (167), 338–351.
Stebbing, L. S. (1933c). Symposium: The “A Priori”. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes 12, 178–196.
Stebbing, L. S. (1934a). A Second Reply to Mr. Joseph. Mind 43 (170), 156–169.
Stebbing, L. S. (1934b). Constructions: The Presidential Address. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 34, 1–30.
Stebbing, L. S. (1934c). Directional Analysis and Basic Facts. Analysis 2 (3), 33–36.
Stebbing, L. S. (1934d). Logic in Practice. London: Methuen.
Stebbing, L. S. (1936). Some Ambiguities in Discussions Concerning Time. In Philosophy and History: Essays Presented to Ernst Cassirer, pp. 107–123. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Stebbing, L. S. (1937a). Nebulous Philosophy – Jeans and Eddington. The American Scholar 6, 71–84.
Stebbing, L. S. (1937b). Philosophy and the Physicists. London: Methuen & Co. Ltd.
Stebbing, L. S. (1939a). Language and Misleading Questions. The Journal of Unified Science 8 (1), 1–6.
Stebbing, L. S. (1939b). Some Puzzles about Analysis. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 39, 69–84.
Stebbing, L. S. (1939c). Thinking to Some Purpose. London: Penguin Books.
Stebbing, L. S. (1941). Ideals and Illusions. London: Watts.
Stebbing, L. S. (1942). Moore’s Influence. In P. A. Schilpp (Ed.), The Philosophy of G.E. Moore, pp. 515–532. London: Cambridge University Press.
Stebbing, L. S. (1943a). A Modern Elementary Logic. London: Methuen.
Stebbing, L. S. (1943b). Physics, Materialism and Free Will. Nature 151, 686–687.
Stebbing, L. S. (1943c). Symposium: The New Physics and Metaphysical Materialism. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 43, 167–184.
Stebbing, L. S. (1944). Men and Moral Principles. London: Oxford University Press.
West, P. (2021). Pause. Reflect. Think. https://aeon.co/essays/on-susan-stebbingand-the-role-of-public-philosophy. Accessed: 2024-05-16.
Willow, M. G. (1995). L. Susan Stebbing. In M. E. Waithe (Ed.), A History of Women Philosophers, Volume 4, pp. 125–155. Springer Science+Business Media Dordrecht.
Wisdom, J. T. (1934). Is Analysis a Useful Method in Philosophy? Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 13(May), 65–89..

Author Information

Teresa Kouri Kissel
Email: tkouri@odu.edu
Old Dominion University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy