Berlin Circle

The Berlin Circle was a group of philosophers and scientists who gathered round Hans Reichenbach in late 1920s. Among its other members, were K. Grelling, C. G. Hempel, D. Hilbert, R. von Mises. The Berlin Circle’s name was Die Gesellschaft für Empirische Philosophie (The Society for Empirical Philosophy). It  joined up with the Vienna Circle. Together they published the journal Erkenntnis that was edited by both Rudolf Carnap and Hans Reichenbach, and they organized several congresses on scientific philosophy, the first of which was held in Prague in 1929.

Members of the Berlin Circle were particularly active in analyzing contemporary physics, especially the theory of relativity, and in developing the frequency interpretation of probability. After the rise of Nazism, several members of the Berlin Circle emigrated from Germany. Reichenbach moved to Turkey in 1933 and then to the USA in 1938; Hempel to Belgium in 1934 and to the USA in 1939; Grelling was killed in a concentration camp. Hence the Berlin Circle was dispersed and never re-united.

Author Information

Mauro Murzi
Italy

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