Maurice Blanchot (1907–2003)

Though Maurice Blanchot’s status as a major figure in 20^th century French thought is indisputable, it is debatable how best to classify his thought and writings. To trace the itinerary of Blanchot’s development as a thinker and writer is to traverse the span of 20^th century French intellectual history, as Blanchot lived through, and engaged with, in some capacity, virtually every single major intellectual movement of the age. Spanning several generations of French philosophy (from the phenomenology of the interwar years, to the structuralism of the 1950s and early 1960s, to the post-structuralism of the 1960s and 1970s), Blanchot’s thought remains strictly irreducible to any of these categories, insofar as it resists enclosure, and responds ceaselessly to the demand of bearing witness to that which is timeless, nameless, and radically other.

Thus far, Blanchot’s greatest influence has arguably been felt in the fields of literature and literary theory. His fictional texts, Thomas the Obscure (1941), Death Sentence (1948), and The Madness of the Day (1949) are among the most unique and challenging texts in 20^th century French literature. His critical essays on Kafka, Rilke, Sade, Mallarmé, and Hölderlin, and his interpretation of the myth of Orpheus, are considered canonical texts in the field of literary studies. His relationship to philosophy, though equally significant, is more nuanced and complex.

While references to philosophical concepts and themes are certainly pervasive throughout his writings, Blanchot eschews formal argumentation and proposes no systematic philosophical theory of his own. Throughout his myriad references to Levinas, Hegel, Nietzsche, Heidegger, and countless others, Blanchot seeks to read philosophers on their own terms, engaging with their respective terminologies, and operating from inside their respective philosophical systems in order to highlight the ways in which these systems inevitably open onto an outside. This tension, between the functioning of a system—be it philosophical, political, textual—and its anarchic, unrepresentable, outside, is a commonly recurring trope within Blanchot’s writings. He is generally less concerned with taking sides on philosophical questions, than in showing how any system or theory that aspires to exhaustive totality undermines itself by assuming a starting point that precedes, or exceeds, the system itself.

Throughout his writings, several other recurrent themes can likewise be discerned. These include an exploration of the paradoxes associated with death, repetition, and time, as well as the various aporias related to origins and ends. Blanchot’s writings show him to be a thinker broadly committed to privileging anonymity and difference over identity and sameness. Though his thinking, particularly with regard to politics, undergoes a series of significant shifts over the course his life, there is a certain consistency to Blanchot’s overall approach. His central concern is to draw philosophy, literature, and theory-at-large, into relation with an otherness, a proverbial outside, beyond its limits—to which it must constantly respond.

Biography and Intellectual Itinerary
Engagement with Major Philosophers
1. Levinas
2. Hegel
3. Nietzsche
4. Heidegger
Key Concepts and Themes
References and Further Reading

1. Biography and Intellectual Itinerary

a. Early Life and Journalism

Blanchot was born in Quain, a town in Saône-et-Loire, in 1907. His family was conservative and Catholic; his father encouraged Blanchot and his siblings to practice Latin at the kitchen-table. Blanchot studied Philosophy and German at the University of Strasbourg, which at the time boasted one of the most extensive libraries in France. It was here, around 1925 or 1926, that Blanchot first met Emmanuel Levinas, and the two became life-long friends. By 1929, Blanchot had relocated to Paris, and briefly pursued, during the early 1930s, the study of medicine at Saint Anne’s Hospital. It was around this time that Blanchot began his first collaborations with the journals of the French far-right. Espousing a vehemently anti-Hitlerian tone, Blanchot’s articles bemoaned the perceived complacency of the French government in addressing the growing threat of German expansionism. Blanchot’s writings from this period have come under considerable scrutiny, in recent years, for their alleged filiation with anti-Semitic currents on the French far-right. An exhaustive examination of all articles signed by Blanchot during the 1930s, however, reveals no instances of racially-exclusionary language or overt anti-Semitism. In his later writings, Blanchot addresses his dubious political commitments of the 1930s, seeking to disambiguate his own youthful involvement in reactionary politics from the anti-Semitism of his one-time associates.

With the outbreak of war in Europe, Blanchot momentarily withdrew from political writing and concentrated his efforts on the writing of fictional texts and literary criticism. His first novel, Thomas the Obscure, was published in 1941, meeting initially with poor reviews in the Parisian press. A second novel, Aminadab, was published a year later, in 1942. During this time, Blanchot was already beginning to develop a distinctive, literary critical voice. His first collection of literary critical essays, Faux pas, appeared in December 1943, featuring texts on a diverse-range of writers, including Mallarmé, Proust, Kierkegaard, Rimbaud, and Melville.

b. Bataille, the War, and the Èze Years

The early 1940s were a particularly formative time in Blanchot’s life. Towards the end of 1940, Blanchot was introduced, by Pierre Prévost, to Georges Bataille. An incredibly close bond would be formed between the two men, lasting until Bataille’s death in 1962. At the time they first met, Bataille was hard at-work on his Nietzsche book, and Bataille’s interpretation of the German philosopher as a radically non-teleological thinker and natural adversary of Hegel would prove immensely influential not only upon Blanchot, but upon an entire generation of French intellectuals. At Bataille’s invitation, Blanchot became a regular participant in the bi-monthly philosophical discussions at 3 rue de Lille, where Blanchot met Denise Rollin, with whom he would later enter into a close relationship. Along with Bataille, Blanchot helped formulate, in late 1942, the abortive project of the “Collège socratique.” In March 1944, Blanchot was present at the famous “Discussion on Sin” organized by Bataille, and attended by Camus, Merleau-Ponty, Sartre, and Klossowski, among others.

Over the decades that followed, Blanchot would frequently engage with Bataille’s highly-influential writings, both directly and indirectly. Of particular importance in chronicling the influence of Bataille, is Blanchot’s 1962 essay, “The Limit-Experience,” later republished in The Infinite Conversation (1969), the 1971 text, Friendship, as well as the first part of Blanchot’s l983 text, The Unavowable Community.

The spring of 1944 was a difficult time for both men. Bataille became quite ill and temporarily left Paris for Samois, while Blanchot himself departed for his family-home in Quain. It was here, in June 1944, that Blanchot was put against the wall by a firing-squad and “mock-executed.” These remarkable, undoubtedly traumatic, circumstances would be later recounted by Blanchot some fifty years later in his text, “The Instant of My Death” (1994). With the surrender of the German army in Paris, on August 25, the war effectively came to an end for Blanchot, who was on the move between Paris and various locales in the south of France throughout 1945 and 1946. It was during this period that Blanchot penned important essays on Kafka, René Char, Nietzsche, and Hölderlin, while assisting Bataille in bringing to publication the first edition of the journal Critique.

The winter of 1946 saw the beginning of a new phase in Blanchot’s life as a writer. He moved for several weeks to a small house in Èze, near Nice, where he lived without electricity and worked on his récits at night. It was over the course of the following years that Blanchot’s reputation as a writer would largely be won. He completed his remarkable, cryptic récit, Death Sentence, in 1947 and saw it published in June 1948. His third (and final) novel, The Most-High, featuring a more political bent, was also published in 1948, followed by the fictional text, The Madness of the Day (1949), and another volume of critical essays, The Work of Fire (1949), which contained the seminal text, “Literature and the Right to Death” (first published in 1948). Rounding-out a decade of incredible productivity, Blanchot’s Lautréamont and Sade was published in 1949.

By this point, Blanchot was producing a new critical essay for publication virtually every couple of weeks. During this period of prolific writing, he continued to move frequently, staying with his brother, René, whenever he found himself in Paris. In September 1949, Blanchot returned to the small house in Èze, which he would make his primary residence until 1957. Here, amidst the “essential solitude” of this medieval village overlooking the Mediterranean coast, Blanchot would write some of the most influential critical essays of his career, including the theoretical writings contained within The Space of Literature (1955).

Indeed, it is perhaps for the writings found within The Space of Literature that Blanchot is most widely-known. Here we find his frequently-cited accounts of the gaze of Orpheus, the two kinds of death, and (in the text’s appendix) the two versions of the imaginary. At the heart of Blanchot’s writings here, which engage in turn with Kafka, Rilke, Mallarmé, and Hölderlin, is a thesis about the radical non-essentiality of literature and the exigency of worklessness (désoeuvrement) which is literature’s aim and concern. If the story of Orpheus and Eurydice is important in this context, it is because Orpheus shows us, in turning back to gaze at Eurydice, a concern for the origin of the work, its absence and inspiration, which overrides any interest in its status as a completed and consummated work. In turning to view Eurydice, Orpheus ruins the work of bringing her out of the darkness, and yet this ruination, Blanchot insists, in his June 1953 essay, reveals what is most essential to literature, namely, its concern for the impossibility and palpable absence that reside at its origin. Literature is less about the completion of great “works,” than it is with maintaining a paradoxical relation with the “worklessness” and impossibility that unravels every work.

This “non-teleological” emphasis, which is also evident in Blanchot’s portrayal of Kafka interminably wandering outside Canaan, is likewise seen in the essay on “The Two Versions of the Imaginary,” first published in 1951, and included as an appendix within The Space of Literature. Here, Blanchot provocatively juxtaposes two versions of the literary image. One version, clearly associated with Hegel and Mallarmé, views the image as the life-giving negation of the thing. It places the thing in question at a distance from us in order to help us understand it in its ideality, thus facilitating productive knowledge. The productive recuperability of this type of image is then contrasted, in Blanchot’s account, by the “other imaginary,” the one which resides outside of the world and its possibilities for knowledge and understanding. Here, the seductive gleam of the image refers us not to the absence of the thing, but to the distance (and difference) that always separates each thing from itself—precluding any possibility for a neat, teleological recuperation. In refusing to subordinate difference to identity and distance to presence, Blanchot is already anticipating the ascendency of the simulacral that will play such a prominent role in the post-structuralist theories of the decades to come.

Beyond his influential literary critical essays, the 1950s also saw the publication of three more, increasingly spare and challenging, récits: When the Time Comes (1951), The One Who Did Not Accompany Me (1953), and The Last Man (1957), in which plot-development and characterization are pared-down to an absolute minimum, as if to highlight the dislocation of presence and the disruption of time to which these texts each bear witness.

c. A Return to Politics

Blanchot’s mother died, in 1957. By all accounts, her passing affected the family greatly. After spending the winter with his brother and sister-in-law in Paris, Blanchot moved into his own flat, on rue Madame, in late summer 1958, beginning a new phase in his intellectual and personal itinerary. The return to Paris, in 1957, was significant in a number of respects. First, it marked a renewed engagement with national politics. Second, it coincided with an increasing focus on questions of an explicitly philosophical nature which called-forth a new, ever more rigorous and demanding style of writing.

The Algiers crisis of 1958, the collapse of the French Fourth Republic, and the rise to power of de Gaulle ushered in a frightening new era in politics. Blanchot, who had not participated in national politics since the 1930s, threw himself into the very middle of the resistance against de Gaulle’s Fifth Republic. Throughout the late summer of 1958, he frequently met-up with Marguerite Duras and Dionys Mascolo (a major influence on Blanchot’s political thinking during this time), and became involved with Mascolo’s anti-Gaullist paper (co-founded with Jean Schuster), Le 14 Juillet. The marked change in Blanchot’s political thinking was clearly evident in his manifesto, “Refusal,” published in October 1958, and in another anti-Gaullist piece, “The Essential Perversion.”

When Francis Jeansen and twenty-three other dissidents were put on trial, in September 1960, for opposing French colonial rule and supporting the Algerian struggle for independence, Blanchot, Mascolo, and a group of other intellectuals, determined to pen a declaration of solidarity with the defendants. The resulting piece, commonly known as the “Manifeste de 121” was written by Blanchot, and declared support for Algerian independence, as well as for those conscripts who refused to be drafted into the conflict. On the heels of this intervention in national politics, Blanchot and Mascolo (along with others) attempted, in 1960, to start an experimental new publication to be called “The International Review.” The publication aspired to solicit short texts on a variety of topics, in three languages (French, German, and Italian), to be written in fragmentary form. Though the ambitious project never fully materialized, it marked an important, early moment in Blanchot’s attempt at rethinking the notion of community beyond borders and fixed identity.

d. Responding to the Other

The late 1950s and early 1960s also saw, in addition to a renewed focus on the political, an emergence of significant stylistic and theoretical innovations in Blanchot’s writing. In October 1958, Blanchot used, for the first time in his published writing, the notion of “le neuter” as a lexical placeholder for the trace of what remains outside of being and non-being. The notion of the neuter would grow in prominence in Blanchot’s writings over the decades to come, comprising one of the most important tropes within his later writings. Around the same time, in 1958, Blanchot published new, important work on Nietzsche, confronting “head-on” the attempted Fascist appropriation of the thinker’s legacy, and seeking to rehabilitate Nietzsche as a thinker intrinsically resistant to all totalizing (Fascist) thought. A year earlier, in 1957, Blanchot had begun work on the text initially entitled “Waiting,” which would eventually reappear within the 1962 text, Awaiting Oblivion. “Waiting” is significant for a couple reasons. It is a text comprised solely of fragments, conjoined loosely by a shared emphasis on the themes of forgetting, waiting, and temporality bereft of presence. In May 1959, these fragments were offered by Blanchot to a Festschrift produced in honor of Heidegger’s 70^th birthday. The publication of Awaiting Oblivion involved a radical subversion of the categories of genre. Readers are left to ponder: Is it a work of experimental fiction? Is it a philosophical text? Or is it something altogether other? With Awaiting Oblivion, Blanchot puts into play a form of fragmentary writing that refuses enclosure within any fixed genre, serving as testimony, rather, to that which escapes all categorization, all thematization, and all definition. It is a text dedicated to radical alterity, and thus, to the neuter itself.

These developments in Blanchot’s thought would soon be supplemented by the writings of an old friend. In 1961, Levinas published his groundbreaking book, Totality and Infinity. Its account of an ethical metaphysics based upon man’s impossible burden of responsibility for the Other, would prove influential upon Blanchot, whose writings, from 1961 onward shift decisively into the domain of the ethico-political. Key to these developments in Blanchot’s thinking is the increasing prominence of the neuter. It is the neuter that Blanchot conceives as a notion that displaces the primacy of ontology and holds open the space of an ethico-political relationship always yet-to-come, always irreducible to fusion, identity, or Oneness. The neuter thus serves as a provocative rejoinder both to Heidegger and Hegel, whose philosophies (though quite different) similarly prioritize, in Blanchot’s view, the totalizing embrace of Being. It is during this period that Blanchot also continues to draw influence from Nietzsche’s texts, in which the exigency of fragmentary writing is given its supreme voice.

Published in 1969, The Infinite Conversation contains critical essays on a host of literary topics (Char, Duras, German Romanticism, Kafka, Flaubert, Roussel), as well as essays dealing with philosophical and theoretical considerations (Levinas, Simone Weil, Nietzsche, Heidegger, Freud, Bataille, Foucault), which are in turn punctuated and disrupted by instances of fragmentation and dialogue between unnamed interlocutors. The Infinite Conversation is undoubtedly Blanchot’s most stylistically diverse text, combining fragmentary texts and more standard literary critical writings, like those found in The Space of Literature or The Book to Come (1959). It is a text without a center-point, without a single unifying theme—unless this theme is the movement of dispersion and dislocation that has always already destabilized all pretense of unity, and exposed all interiority to that which is radically outside it.

During the events of May 1968, Blanchot found himself at the heart of the anti-authoritarian movement as a member of the Comité d’action étudiants-écrivains. Penning numerous, unsigned pieces for the group’s magazine, Comité, Blanchot espoused a radical politics based upon a rejection of all forms of hitherto existing political order: a communism without communism. By mid-1969, however, Blanchot had distanced himself from the group, citing as a reason (in a letter to Levinas) its position in support of Palestine and opposition to the state of Israel.

As the 1970s began, a veritable changing of the guard was underway. As post-structuralism entered its zenith, with Derrida and Deleuze producing many of their seminal writings, Blanchot’s health began to decline precipitously and death seemed all around him. Jean Paulhan passed away in 1969, then Paul Celan drowned himself in the Seine in April 1970. Blanchot himself endured hospitalization in the early 1970s, and in early 1972 wrote letters to his closest friends thanking them, as though retrospectively, for a life in which he was privileged to meet them. His 1973 text, The Step Not Beyond, which was written entirely in the fragmentary form, resembles at times a meditation on death—though less as a statement of its impending reality, than as a testimony to its interminable impossibility. Consigning us to a time without present, the act of writing, Blanchot insists, makes the process of dying endless and the instant of death unattainable.

e. Writing the Disaster

Many of these themes reemerge in his 1980 text, The Writing of the Disaster, only supplemented by a somewhat broader panoply of accompanying themes and emphases. Present here are explicit references to Levinas, a staple in Blanchot’s texts since the early 1960s, and Hegel—but these perennial sources of inspiration and provocation are accompanied now by a host of unexpected, other voices. Blanchot devotes space to an engagement with the psychoanalysts Serge Leclaire and D. W. Winnicott on the topics of narcissism and the primal scene; he references Melville’s “Bartleby,” and offers fragments on Derrida, Deleuze and Guattari, Heidegger’s obsession with etymology, and Nietzsche’s views on the Jews, among many other topics. At the heart of Blanchot’s text is the notion of the disaster itself. Not merely synonymous with the Holocaust, the dispersive force of the neuter, or the “impossible necessary death” (The Writing of the Disaster, p. 67) that has always already preceded (and ruined) every installation of subjective, egoic mastery—the polysemy of the disaster includes traces of each of these meanings, without being in any way reducible to a single fixed meaning or concept.

Crucially, the disaster remains outside of all presence, beyond representation, and divorced from possibility and truth. It is wholly “otherwise” than being or non-being. Yet, despite the disaster’s exteriority (and anteriority) with respect to each of these classic, philosophical notions, it is the disaster that accords each of these notions its respective meaning, on the condition that this meaning never coincide fully with itself. The disaster has always already touched, inhabited, compromised, and ruined every worldly edifice predicated upon stability, totality, unity, and Oneness before it can even be founded. The disaster is a “name” for that which turns every subject, every text, every historical narrative, and every political system ceaselessly outside itself, toward the radical alterity that escapes its enclosure, and serves as its condition of both possibility and impossibility.

Blanchot followed this, arguably his most challenging text, with another important text, The Unavowable Community, in late 1983. Here Blanchot lays out, with reference to Bataille and the novelist Marguerite Duras, among others, a rethinking of the notion of community as irreducible to the notions of self-identity and presence. A small book, entitled A Voice From Elsewhere, appeared in 1992, and final, striking piece of short fiction, “The Instant of My Death,” was published in 1994. Blanchot passed away on February 20, 2003.

2. Engagement with Major Philosophers

a. Levinas

Blanchot and Levinas first met in Strasbourg in 1925 while studying philosophy. They soon developed a deep friendship that would last until Levinas’s death in 1995. Various anecdotes from their friendship are well-known. We know, for instance, that it was Levinas who first introduced Blanchot to Heidegger’s Being and Time in the late 1920s. A little over a decade later, it was Blanchot who helped secure a safe-haven for Levinas’s wife and daughter in a monastery during the war. Yet anecdotes like these can only offer a superficial sense of the profound bond that came to be formed between these two men, so different in their respective backgrounds, beliefs, and interests. The mutual debt of influence shared between them would alter each of their intellectual paths irrevocably, and serve as a catalyst for some of the most important developments in Blanchot’s own thinking.

When Blanchot, throughout his writings, engages with the ideas of Levinas (whom he considered, along with Bataille, his closest friend), it is never Blanchot’s strategy merely to repeat, uncritically, Levinas’s philosophical doctrines, much less to appropriate them as his own. Rather, Blanchot pays tribute to Levinas most devoutly at the precise moments in his texts when he accentuates the difference, and distance, between himself and Levinas. Fidelity to one’s friend, Blanchot suggests, requires a measure of compulsory infidelity. It is by bearing witness to the differences between himself and Levinas that Blanchot most eloquently testifies unto the profundity of their relationship.

Levinas’s name appears for the first time in Blanchot’s published work in a footnote to “Literature and the Right to Death,” published in 1947. And though explicit references to Levinas are rare within Blanchot’s voluminous critical output of the 1940s and 1950s, the presence of certain Levinasian tropes is nevertheless unmistakable during this period. Chief among these is the il y a, which both Levinas and Blanchot attempt to construe as a challenge to the fundamental ontology of Heidegger, as well as to Hegel’s philosophy of death. It is not until 1961, with the publication of Levinas’s Totality and Infinity, that Blanchot undertakes an explicit engagement with Levinas’s philosophy. This engagement initially takes the form of three chapters devoted to Levinasian philosophy in The Infinite Conversation (1969), and is then followed by numerous fragments in the pages of The Writing of the Disaster (1980), and a retrospective of their friendship (“Our Clandestine Companion”).

Whereas the scope of Blanchot’s earlier (1940s-1950s) allusions to Levinasian thought are limited primarily to a consideration of the il y a and its bearing upon the ontological status of the work of art (or literature), at the heart of these post-1961 engagements one finds a noticeable shift of attention and emphasis towards the ethico-political sphere—a move carried out in direct response to the provocative new directions introduced within Levinas’s own thought. Of major importance within Levinas’s philosophy during this period is the figure of the “Other” (Autrui). Standing in sharp contrast to the notion of otherness that had predominated throughout the Western philosophical tradition, Levinas’s Other does not admit of thematization, mediation, or reciprocity. This Other is radically irreducible to any notion of the Same or the Self. To stand in relation to the Other is to exist in “infinite relation” with that which shatters all forms of totality, abiding beyond both being and non-being. Moreover, as Levinas maintains, the Other burdens the subject with an ethical responsibility that is both impossible to decline and impossible to fulfill satisfactorily. This ethical relation is not chosen, but imposed upon the subject. It demands that the subject put the Other before all else.

It is in the context of these philosophical developments that Blanchot, without accepting any of this uncritically or without reservation, enters into explicit dialogue with Levinas’s texts, from 1961 onward. In the broadest of terms, what Blanchot aims to do, across these various engagements, is to explore ways in which the relation with absolute alterity described by Levinas might allow us to rethink the nature of human relations and community. In this sense, Blanchot is neither adopting Levinasian philosophy as his own, nor contradicting it, but rather pushing it toward its limit, to the point where the Levinasian philosophy of Transcendence, whose religious overtones loom large, opens onto a new form of secular humanism grounded in a concrete emphasis on ethico-political responsibility.

To move in this direction, Blanchot accords the Levinasian philosophy a privileged position within his texts, all the while refusing to spare it critique, interrogation, or transposition. Throughout his writings of the 1960s and beyond, Blanchot does not cease to pose probing questions towards Levinas’s texts. Who exactly is this Other to whom Levinas refers? Is it possible to name the Other as such without compromising his radical alterity? What is the meaning of the “ethics” to which Levinas refers? Is such an ethical comportment exclusive to believers of the Jewish faith? Is it dependent upon a belief in the Jewish God?

Difficult questions such as these are neither avoided by Blanchot, nor accorded facile resolution. Rather, they are explored in all their complexity and allowed to ramify and redouble themselves throughout the pages of Blanchot’s writings. Though he remains thoroughly committed to a rigorous atheologism, Blanchot acknowledges, in light of Levinas’s writings of the early 1960s, the profound philosophical importance of Judaism. What makes Judaism so distinctive, so philosophically important, according to Blanchot, is both its “nomadic” essence and the privilege it accords to man’s sacred responsibility for the Other. Unlike Heidegger’s “pagan” philosophy, for example, which situates truth in rooted dwelling and permanence, Blanchot highlights the impressive manner in which the “truth” of Judaism develops amidst exile, dispersion, and up-rootedness. Moreover, it is Judaism which accords an unparalleled importance to mankind’s relation (of non-relation) with the infinite.

Yet while Levinas understands this relationship to the (transcendent) Other primarily in terms of the paradigmatic “asymmetry” of man’s rapport with God, Blanchot seeks to reconfigure this relationship in terms of the “double dissymmetry” of a relation between two or more human beings. Where the Levinasian account stresses hierarchy and places emphasis upon the verticality of man’s relationship with the Most-High, Blanchot proposes a non-hierarchical relationship between human beings that is irreducible to unity or duality. Dissymmetry, in the Blanchotian account, means that the relation (of non-relation) between the Self and the Other, is redoubled by the Other’s relation (of non-relation) with respect to the Self. Importantly, this redoubling does not lead, in Blanchot’s account, to any dialectic of reciprocity or recognition. It is not the presence of the divine, as in Levinas’s ethical metaphysics, that saddles the Self with infinite responsibility; rather, it is the presence of one’s own neighbor, one’s fellow man, that introduces a burden of responsibility that can neither be satisfied nor ignored.

While Blanchot remains skeptical of Levinas’s heavy reliance upon a conceptual lexicon (God, the Other, ethics, and so forth) which seems to betray the very alterity it seeks to evoke, he senses in Levinas’s project (and in Judaic philosophy, more broadly) a provocative antidote to the philosophies of totality. Blanchot senses, moreover, within Levinasian philosophy, a precedent for rethinking the meaning of social responsibility and community outside of the economy of being. The influence of Levinas’s philosophy upon Blanchot’s thinking, particularly from 1961 onward, is thus far-reaching and profound.

b. Hegel

Much as thinkers of the medieval period would have referred to Aristotle simply as the philosopher, for Blanchot, it is Hegel who most embodies the discourse of philosophy construed as a systematic whole. As Blanchot writes in The Infinite Conversation, Hegel is the thinker “in whom philosophy comes together and accomplishes itself” (The Infinite Conversation, p. 4). Hegelian philosophy thus becomes the backdrop for much of what Blanchot has to say, not only about philosophy proper, but also about history and literature. What Hegel represents is the false-promise of totality in all its various forms (epistemological, ontological, political, historical, and textual). The “Hegelian system” becomes an emblem for every system, that is, for every attempt at achieving exhaustive, irrefutable self-enclosure—whether this be construed as a system of Absolute Knowledge or even something like Mallarmé’s “Absolute Book.”

Confronted by a discourse that seeks authority and mastery over “the All,” Blanchot’s strategy, in reading Hegel, is to position himself obliquely, along the margins of Hegel’s text, neither opposing Hegel directly, nor endorsing him. A Blanchotian reading will typically follow the author of the Phenomenology up to the point where the text begins to unravel on the basis of its own logic and its philosophy gives way to aporia. Two early examples of this can be found in Blanchot’s essays from 1947 and 1948, entitled respectively, “The Spiritual Animal Kingdom” and “Literature and the Right to Death.” Here we find Blanchot, under the influence of a Kojèveian reading of Hegel, coming to highlight the paradoxes implied by the notions of death and negativity in Hegel’s text.

Not unlike Bataille, Blanchot senses an air of fraudulence surrounding the Hegelian system’s pretense of enclosure. Beginning with Kojève’s thesis that Hegel’s philosophy is a philosophy of death, Blanchot wonders what happens to this negativity, which serves as the driving force for all history, once history has arrived at its end-point. Moreover, if negativity is precisely what provokes the dialectic of history into motion in the first place, then does this not assign to negativity a position simultaneously “before” and “beyond” the very system in question? Such excess, or non-recuperable exteriority, is precisely what Hegel’s system seems to presuppose and yet simultaneously reject. This means that the coherence of the Hegelian system depends upon the very thing that it excludes. Pointing out this dependency of the inside upon the outside is a frequently recurring Blanchotian trope, and it is used with great effect here, with respect to Hegel. As Blanchot himself writes in The Writing of the Disaster, “What exceeds the system is the impossibility of its failure, and likewise the impossibility of its success” (The Writing of the Disaster, p. 47).

By the late 1960s and early 1970s, Hegel’s name is increasingly juxtaposed, in Blanchot’s texts, with the name Nietzsche. If Hegel is seen by Blanchot as the great totalizer, then Nietzsche, on the other hand, is the thinker without enclosure, without a Hauptwerk, without a system, and without any doctrine that would not, simultaneously, suspend itself. If Hegel, moreover, is the great thinker of possibility (the basis of which, according to the Kojèveian interpretation, is death), then it is Nietzsche who comes to emblematize, for Blanchot, the vertigo of eternal return which contests every origin and every end, suspending the work of death, and consigning us to the impossibility of dying.

c. Nietzsche

Blanchot’s Nietzsche is a complex figure positioned both within metaphysics and “always already” outside it. He is, as Blanchot asserts in 1958, “the last philosopher” (The Infinite Conversation, p. 141), a thinker whose texts comprise the culminating event in Western metaphysics. At the same time, Blanchot insists, Nietzsche is outside metaphysics, gesturing us toward the dispersive, the fragmentary, and the incommunicable. During his decades-long engagement with Nietzsche’s thought, Blanchot offers incisive commentary on a wide variety of topics: nihilism, the Last Man, the Will to Power, Dionysus, the philosophy of time, the future, the Death of God, perspectivism, and ecstastic experience. Moreover, Blanchot’s texts from the late 1950s onward demonstrate an acute sensitivity to the political efficacy and political baggage of Nietzsche’s thought. Acknowledging Nietzsche’s horrific appropriation by fascist ideologues during the 1930s and 1940s, Blanchot nevertheless seeks to portray Nietzsche as a paradigmatically non-systematic thinker, whose thought (if followed rigorously and without compromise) resists all attempts at appropriation and mastery. To the extent that one reads Nietzsche attentively, one sees him to be a thinker at odds with all forms of totality, totalitarianism, and anti-Semitism.

Blanchot’s first substantive engagement with Nietzsche’s philosophy appears in late 1945. Here, in an essay entitled “On Nietzsche’s Side,” Blanchot reinscribes Karl Jaspers’ seminal thesis on Nietzsche, namely, that the “essential impulse” of Nietzsche’s thought resides in the tendency toward self-contradiction. Showing, once more, the influence of Kojève, these incessant contradictions do not, according to Blanchot, “get to rest in some higher synthesis, but hold themselves together by an increasing tension” (The Work of Fire, p. 290). This tendency of Nietzsche’s thought to contradict itself without resolution points toward the broader role which Nietzsche will play within Blanchot’s texts as spokesperson par excellence for non-teleological thinking.

Central to this non-teleological capacity of Nietzsche’s thought is the notion of the eternal return. Following immediately upon the heels of Klossowski’s “Forgetting and Anamnesis” paper (1964), Blanchot begins to develop, in the mid-1960s, a distinctive and radical reading of the eternal return which views Nietzsche’s “thought of thoughts” less as a doctrine, than as a simulacrum of a doctrine. In the pages of The Infinite Conversation, Blanchot proposes a novel thesis concerning the reason for Zarathustra’s (and Nietzsche’s own) regimen of postponement and deferral with respect to the proclamation of the message of eternal recurrence. This postponement, Blanchot argues, should not be attributed to some contingent incapacity on the part of the speaker to articulate the thought faithfully or exhaustively, but rather, to the thought’s radical aversion to all presence. The eternal return is continuously deferred from all thought, according to Blanchot, because deferral of all presence is the very meaning of the thought itself. What “returns”— if anything—is an event that has never been present; or rather, an event that hollows out presence itself.

By the time of The Step Not Beyond (1973), Blanchot’s writing on Nietzsche becomes increasingly oblique. In a set of remarks penned in direct response to Klossowski’s Nietzsche and the Vicious Circle, but also suggesting engagement with Deleuze’s late-1960s work on the eternal return, Blanchot suggests that “dissymmetry is at work in repetition itself” (The Step Not Beyond, p. 42), meaning that the past does not repeat the future in the same way that the future repeats the past. Further reinscription of the thought of eternal return occurs in The Writing of the Disaster, where Blanchot repeatedly evokes a modality of temporal repetition that has always already dislodged presence, suspended the present, and withdrawn from the Self any basis upon which to construct a coherent notion of self-identity or subjectivity.

d. Heidegger

The provocation posed by Heidegger to French theory during the mid-20^th century is well-documented. From Sartre and Lacan, to Levinas and Derrida, the imposing demand of Heidegger’s philosophy weighed heavily upon countless thinkers. In this respect, Blanchot was no exception. Blanchot’s good comprehension of German, and his early exposure to Heidegger’s work (he was introduced to it via Levinas, in the late 1920s), made a significant engagement with the author of Being and Time perhaps inevitable.

Over the span of Blanchot’s published writings, we find countless instances of substantive engagement with Heidegger’s thought, initially on issues pertaining to the work of art, poetics, and Hölderlin. Later, these engagements would come to include a deeper questioning of the status of Being, the problem of nihilism, and the notion of futurity, among other topics. Throughout his post-war writings, Blanchot displays acute sensitivity and great nuance in dealing with Heidegger’s legacy as a thinker once ensnared by the allure of National-Socialism. On one hand, Blanchot is quick to acknowledge that, in committing his philosophical lexicon to the cause of the Nazi party in a public endorsement of Hitler in 1933, Heidegger had cast boundless suspicion over his own discourse and forever tarnished it; on the other hand, Blanchot sees Heidegger’s philosophy as worthy of commentary and to a certain extent inescapable as a point of reference, insofar as it presents (like Hegel, but in a different register) an account of the totalizing embrace of Being. Heidegger’s challenge to philosophy is a challenge that is impossible to ignore.

As early as his review of Sartre’s Nausea, in 1938, Blanchot can already be seen insisting upon the importance of Heidegger’s account of the crisis faced by modern art. And though explicit references to Heidegger during the wartime years are rare, it is clear that Blanchot had already assimilated, by this time, much of Heidegger’s thinking. Nowhere is this more evident than in Blanchot’s early writings on Hölderlin, which strongly reflect a Heideggerean bent. For Heidegger, Dichtung (which means “poetry” in common parlance, but also refers etymologically to the notion of “invention”) comes to be privileged as the most essential type of artwork because it serves as the basis for Dasein’s historical being, as well as serving as the origin of language itself. According to Heidegger, all genuine work of artistic creativity has Dichtung at its origin. Blanchot, in the early 1940s, follows Heidegger by insisting upon the privileged role of poetic language as foundational with respect to the world. It is poetic language that inaugurates a world and discloses the human subject.

Only around 1946, with the publication of his “The ‘Sacred’ Word of Hölderlin,” does Blanchot begin to take a noticeable distance from Heidegger. In this essay, Blanchot finally rejects the Heideggerian reconciliation between Dichtung and Being, and offers an account of Hölderlin’s poetic work that views it less as an act of ontological foundation, than as a site of irresolvable tension wherein the poem ceaselessly confronts its own impossibility and groundlessness.

By the time of Blanchot’s 1952 essay “Literature and the Original Experience,” the similarities and differences between his and Heidegger’s views on art and poetry are even more starkly defined. What the two thinkers share, in a general sense, is a refusal of any aesthetic philosophy based upon the distinction between form and content, subject and object. Moreover, each thinker builds his account from an initial confrontation with Hegel’s Aesthetics, and its famous injunction that “art today is a thing of the past.” But whereas Heidegger insists upon the work’s privileged relation to truth (as “unconcealment”), and hence to the world, Blanchot develops an account of art and literature that stresses their radical exteriority with respect to the world, work, and truth.

Nor is Blanchot’s engagement with Heidegger by any means limited to aesthetics. In the midst of his return to national politics, and his in-depth immersion into the philosophy of Nietzsche, Blanchot offers an important commentary, in 1958, on Heidegger’s exchange with the philosopher Ernst Jünger on the aporias of nihilism. Shortly thereafter, Blanchot is invited to contribute a piece of writing for inclusion within Heidegger’s 70^th birthday Festschrift. This piece, entitled “Waiting,” is comprised of a series of fragments, marking Blanchot’s first published foray into a textual form that would assert itself with increasing prominence in his writings over the decades that followed. In this piece, which was later republished with substantial revisions and additions as part of the 1962 text, Awaiting Oblivion, Blanchot describes a type of waiting devoid of transitivity, in which time is no longer measured as a succession of present “now-moments,” but left free from all appropriation and calculation. Waiting here does not refer to an anticipation for something or someone which could ever come to occupy a moment of fixed-presence. Rather, it signifies a waiting for a moment that dislodges chronological temporality: a waiting for nothing other than waiting itself.

Blanchot pays tribute here to the influence of Heidegger in this account of non-representational, post-metaphysical temporality, and yet, as Blanchot’s essay on Heraclitus, first published in 1960, makes clear, a profound divergence in their respective approaches has occurred. While Heidegger’s Heraclitus famously offers us an insight into the unconcealment of Being, Blanchot proposes to read the Heraclitian fragments as an instance of language construed not as a shelter for Being, but as a response to the radical alterity of that which remains outside of Being altogether. Here, as in so much of Blanchot’s writings of the 1960s and 1970s, language assumes a double function as that which names the possible—but also bears witness to that which infinitely precedes and exceeds all ontology. Moving somewhat away from the notion of the il y a, which was still an ontological construct (albeit a subversive one), Blanchot increasingly deploys the notion of the neuter, a pseudo-concept intended to displace all ontological primacy. Having nothing to do with either being or non-being, the neuter serves as a condition of both possibility and impossibility for Heidegger’s ontological framework, implicitly turning aside the question of the meaning of Being, and upstaging it with the more urgent question of the other.

3. Key Concepts and Themes

a. Two Kinds of Death

Blanchot’s account of the so-called “two kinds of death” is a well-known component of his literary criticism of the 1950s and a recurrent point of emphasis in his ongoing dialogue with the philosophies of Hegel and Heidegger.

For Hegel, as Blanchot notes, death is what produces all possibility of meaning in the world by serving as the catalyst for the dialectic itself. Death is constantly put to work and subsequently recuperated, in Hegel’s system, leading history toward its point of inevitable culmination. For Heidegger, death is likewise related to the notion of possibility. More specifically, it is construed, in Being and Time, as one’s own possibility, a possibility which is non-transferable and not to be outstripped. It comprises the very basis for Dasein’s authentic existence.

In his writings, Blanchot does not directly oppose these accounts of death. What Blanchot suggests, however, is that there is also another side to death which these philosophies marginalize or exclude. It is a side in which the power and possibility of death are suspended. It is this phenomenon to which Rainer Maria Rilke, in a letter from 1910, seeks to bear witness with the words: “Nothing is possible for me anymore, not even dying.” Here, all desire for a masterful, self-actualizing, proper death is forestalled by the realization that death, in fact, is never accessible for the self.

In a manner somewhat reminiscent of Epicurus, Blanchot argues that this second kind of death is incommensurable with any subjective, or personal, experience. Commenting on death in The Space of Literature, Blanchot writes, “I have no relationship with it, it is that toward which I cannot go, for in it I do not die, I have fallen from the power to die. In it they die; they do not cease, and they do not finish dying” (The Space of Literature, p. 155). Thus death, which for Hegel and Heidegger is associated with possibility, comes to be contrasted with the anguish of anonymous death, which is impossible for the Self, and can neither be willed, mastered, or even undergone by any personal subject—in the present.

By articulating this doubleness associated with the notion of death, Blanchot is able to challenge both Hegel and Heidegger on fundamental points of their respective philosophies. If death contains within itself this trace of impersonality that expels all attempts at mastery, propriety, and power, then the consequences of this are significant. The so-called work of the concept in Hegel, which is powered by death, must now be understood as silently accompanied by worklessness and impossibility. Likewise, in the context of Heidegger’s thought, if death is double, then no death can ever be wholly proper or authentic. In contrast to all philosophies, going back to Plato, in which death is equated with Truth, presence, or consummation, Blanchot thus seeks to emphasize the error, absence, and interminability associated with dying. In short, Blanchot is showing that death remains a radically indeterminable, or volatile, concept whose inclusion within any system poses not only a challenge to systemic coherency, but also to definitive closure.

b. The il y a

The notion of the il y a, which means “there is,” appears prominently throughout Blanchot’s writings and comprises one of the most direct links between his texts and those of early Levinas. Though the trope of the il y a appears in Blanchot’s literary writings dating back to the mid-1930s (“The Last Word”), its most significant early deployment occurs in Blanchot’s novel Thomas the Obscure, which Levinas then explicitly references in his 1947 text, Existence and Existents. Blanchot and Levinas thus develop the notion of the il y a somewhat in tandem during the period in question, influencing one another, while gradually coming to propose subtly different points of emphasis in their respective usages of the phrase.

The il y a features two seemingly contradictory traits. First, it involves the presence of the absence of being. Second, it points toward the inescapability of being or its radical resistance to negation. In coming to formulate these difficult notions, Blanchot and Levinas are engaging critically with the account of fundamental ontology offered in Heidegger’s Being and Time. In contrast to Heidegger’s insistence upon the primacy of being-in-the-world, Blanchot and Levinas seek to articulate a more “primal” ontological state, namely, one which involves the notion of being unmoored from all objects. It is a state characterized by the sheer absence of a world. In the midst of the il y a, the world and its possibilities vanish, leaving as a palpable residue the preconceptual singularity of being itself. Gone is the original generosity of the Heideggerian “gift of Being.” In its place, Blanchot and Levinas assert the vertiginous horror of objectless being, sheer anonymity, and insomniac wakefulness. The il y a thus signifies something even more archaic than ontological difference; it involves a state which serves subversively as a condition of both possibility and impossibility for the Heideggerian distinction between being (Sein) and beings (das Seiende).

This status of serving as both a condition of possibility and impossibility is indeed crucial to the notion of the il y a. As a foundational point, the il y a shows itself to undermine the very things it conditions. Because it serves as a condition for all propositions, whether affirmative or negative, the il y a necessarily remains impervious to the force of negation. When everything else has been negated (at the end of history), the murmur of the indestructible il y a remains. Moreover, to the extent that it serves as a condition for the world of objects, the il y a poses an inevitable threat to the sense and meaning of the world itself, by confronting the world with an objectless void that precedes and exceeds it. The il y a is what interrupts both Heidegger’s being-in-the world and Hegel’s dialectic by exposing them to something that is unassimilable and foreign, yet necessarily intimate and immersive.

Blanchot begins to move subtly beyond the limits of the Levinasian account of the il y a when he turns this discussion back toward the question of literature. According to Blanchot, what literature seeks as its aim is nothing other than this very state of preconceptual singularity. Literature, Blanchot insists, seeks to bear witness neither to worldly meaning, conceptual truth, nor subjective experience, but rather to a state which precedes all meaning, truth, and subjective experience. Literature, therefore, is both conditioned by the il y a and aims to return toward it. This is what grants the literary work its unique status in Blanchot’s thought: in order to exist, the literary work must necessarily harbor within itself the murmur of the il y a (the work’s origin) which is synonymous with the absence of the work. The work thus contains within itself the trace of its own dissolution, since what makes it possible also puts it in touch with its own impossibility. This emphasis on circularity is a key aspect of Blanchot’s unique interpretation of the il y a, and it is a circularity which, in spite of the vertigo it involves, demands to be radically affirmed

Periodic references to the il y a continue to appear well into Blanchot’s later writings. Its importance as a trope, however, is largely displaced, from the early 1960s onward, by an even more provocative pseudo-concept that Blanchot calls “the neuter.” Whereas the il y a remains situated, at least nominally, within the economy of being and non-being (even as it challenges this economy), the neuter suspends the question of being or non-being altogether and remains radically irreducible to any ontology whatsoever. While the il y a, in the writings of Blanchot and Levinas, evokes the groundless ground of all being, or as Blanchot puts it, the impossibility of not-being, the neuter gestures us even further, toward the very limit of philosophy as such.

c. The Neuter

The neuter is one of the most difficult concepts in Blanchot’s critical apparatus. We might casually think of the neuter as a kind of third gender opposed to the strictly male or female genders. But this is an approach that Blanchot rejects. The neuter is not a gender or a genre of any kind, he insists. It is not a class of beings. Indeed, for Blanchot, the neuter is set apart from everything visible and invisible, everything present and absent. It is commensurable no less with a subject than with an object. The neuter is not of this world, or any world, for that matter. And yet, it is by no means transcendent either. The neuter stands outside of all totality, all unity, all Oneness. It withdraws itself, or effaces itself, the very moment it is uttered or inscribed. The neuter is precisely a (nameless) name for the movement of thought that draws every word and every concept ceaselessly towards its outside, its other.

In practical terms, the neuter evokes a word’s ability to suspend and remark itself in such a way that it ceases to signify what it signifies, and it begins to drift into the indeterminacy of multiple meanings. The neuter is a kind of principle of “original” difference and differentiation that both conditions and threatens the installation of all forms of self-identity, meaning, and truth. It thus bears striking similarities to Derrida’s “différance” to the extent that the neuter establishes the non-coincidence of language with itself. If language is understood in terms of the differential relations between signs, then it is the neuter which has always already brought this difference into play. The neuter is what exposes every word to an infinity of meanings, making language possible on the condition that it is constantly traversed by a radical alterity that both precedes and exceeds it.

Blanchot’s “discovery” of the neuter (in the early 1960s, in this sense, though the term had been used previously in his writings) was highly impactful on the development of his thought as a whole. It is widely known that nearly all of the chapters in Blanchot’s 1969 text, The Infinite Conversation, had been previously published as stand-alone articles in journals such as the Nouvelle Revue française. Significantly, many of these original articles were substantially modified by Blanchot in the years that elapsed between their initial publication (some date all the way back to the mid-1950s) and their ultimate inclusion within the pages of The Infinite Conversation. These revisions reflect a shift in Blanchot’s work that began to take place in the 1960s, and that impact his views on being, language, and philosophy rather dramatically. Integral to this shift is the emergence of the neuter in Blanchot’s theory and writings. His revisions leading up to the publication of The Infinite Conversation reflect this increasing awareness of the neuter’s capacity for displacing, suspending, and ungrounding the very language of philosophy that it conditions.

Thus, in the 1969 republished versions his earlier articles, Blanchot places scare-quotes around the words “being” and “presence,” replaces the word “logos” with “difference,” and substitutes the terms “impersonal” and “anonymous” with “neuter.” These changes are anything but cosmetic. Rather, they reflect a concerted effort on Blanchot’s part to assert the trace of otherness and difference at the heart of philosophy and language. By no means merely an exercise in semantics, the emergence of the neuter, in Blanchot’s writings of the 1960s, goes hand-in-hand with the increasing emphasis on the ethico-political that comes to the fore in his work around the same time, largely in response to developments in Levinas’s thought. “Every encounter,” Blanchot writes, “where the Other suddenly looms up and obliges thought to leave itself, just as it obliges the Self to come up against the lapse that constitutes it and from which it protects itself—is already marked, already fringed by the neutral” (The Infinite Conversation, p. 306).

In The Writing of the Disaster, Blanchot calls the neuter, alongside the notions of the outside, the disaster, and return, the “four winds of the spirit’s absence…the names of thought, when it lets itself come undone and, by writing, fragment” (The Writing of the Disaster, p. 57). The neuter, like the disaster, refers to a movement of thought beyond meaning, that makes meaning possible (on the condition that it never be identical to itself). Together, these notions comprise Blanchot’s most rigorously elaborated tropes for thinking (the non-thought of) the absolute alterity of the outside.

d. Community and the Political

There are several phases to Blanchot’s engagement with politics, making any all-encompassing encapsulation of his views on the topic nearly impossible. Just as his thinking about major issues of philosophical and literary importance undergoes alteration in the sixty-plus years of his career as a mature writer—so, too, do his views on politics evolve greatly.

One can readily identify a very early phase, spanning roughly the decade of the 1930s, during which Blanchot contributed numerous articles and essays to the journals of the French far-right. These articles espoused a virulently anti-Hitlerian rhetoric and took a dim view of any attempts at appeasement or compromise with regard to the growing German menace. Problematically, though, the immediate target of Blanchot’s derision in these pieces was often the parliamentary French government, with its perceived weakness in the face of the Nazi threat. Blanchot’s advocacy, during this period, of terrorism against the liberal state as a means of “national salvation” showed a clear, antidemocratic bent to his early thinking. Much later in his writings, Blanchot came to address this period through a self-critical lens, claiming that despite his youthful participation in French nationalist circles, he consciously refused association with anti-Semitic elements on the far-right.

Between the start of the Second World War and 1957, Blanchot assumed a largely apolitical stance, spending much time in the south of France, and producing an extraordinarily prolific outpouring of literary texts and critical essays. With his return to Paris in 1957, Blanchot reentered the sphere of national politics. He soon developed a close friendship with Dionys Mascolo, who would launch, in July 1958, the paper Le 14 Juillet, alongside Jean Schuster. The paper was oriented around resistance to General de Gaulle’s return to power, and Blanchot elected to write two important articles for publication. Central to Blanchot’s opposition to the regime was his staunch refusal of de Gaulle’s claim to embody the French national destiny. Blanchot saw de Gaulle’s recourse to the rhetoric of national salvation and a quasi-religious politics as a perversion of the highest order. Such perversion, according to Blanchot, demanded vigorous opposition and categorical refusal. By 1958, therefore, one can see Blanchot explicitly and forcefully rejecting precisely the kind of politics (based on military might, patriotism, and national salvation) that he had advocated as a young journalist in the 1930s.

If anything, Blanchot’s politics in the years that followed his initial collaboration with Mascolo’s paper only grew more progressive, more radical. In September 1960, when twenty-four French and Algerian dissidents were put on trial for subverting the French colonial efforts in Algeria, Blanchot was a driving force behind the production of the so-called “Manifeste de 121,” a text which endorsed the right of Frenchmen to refuse to be drafted in to the Algerian conflict, and voiced support for Algerian independence. Along with Mascolo, and several others, Blanchot then sought to channel his efforts on the “Manifeste” into an even more ambitious project: the creation of an international journal of “total criticism,” which would meld together political, literary, and scientific discussions. This “International Review” would be published in three languages (French, German, and Italian), in a format comprised primarily of fragments. By early 1964, however, the project for this experimental journal was abandoned.

Blanchot’s participation in left-wing politics, however, would not wane. During the évenéments of May 1968, Blanchot became a member of the Comité d’action étudiants-écrivains, a group of revolutionary students and writers who agitated against the government and passionately rejected all forms of representational politics predicated upon the pursuit of power. As a member of this radical group, Blanchot anonymously penned numerous texts for its semi-secret magazine, Comité. By March 1969, though, the group had begun to break apart, and Blanchot himself disavowed any further participation in it, due to the group’s position (which was then common in extreme leftist circles) against Israel and in favor of Palestine.

Blanchot thus carried with him, into the 1970s, 1980s, and beyond, a rather unique political style combining aspects of left-wing radicalism, social justice advocacy (as seen, for example, in his writings against apartheid, in support of Salman Rushdie, and later, in favor of gay rights), and unwavering support for the state of Israel. Indeed, the impossible memory of the camps, and the burden of responsibility associated with it, factors heavily into the fragments that came to comprise Blanchot’s texts, The Step Not Beyond and The Writing of the Disaster. The Holocaust looms particularly large, here, as a catastrophic provocation in relation to which all forms of politics whatsoever must be judged, calling forth a political response which rejects all forms of totality or totalitarianism, demanding an infinite attentiveness to the other.

Blanchot refers, at times, to such a politics as “communism.” A Blanchotian form of communism, however, would exclude all forms of preexisting community. Such a communism would have no historical or theoretical precedent. It would be, strictly speaking, a communism solely of the future, one that would reject all forms of previously established communal order. As the etymology here suggests, rethinking communism involves nothing less than rethinking the meaning of community itself. This is a project that Blanchot, inspired by the work of Phillipe Lacoue-Labarthe and Jean-Luc Nancy, embarked upon in his 1983 text, The Unavowable Community, and which comprises one of the major focuses of his later writings.

The politics evoked within these writings reject any notion of community based on the notion of fusion, communion, or nationalism. They emphasize, instead, a double demand. First, to affirm the necessity of a break, a rupture, in the dialectical development of political history. This involves proactive political engagement, agitation, and advocacy. Secondly, though, beyond this demand to create an interruption in the politics of possibility through concrete, worldly intervention, there is the requirement of bearing witness to an infinite demand for justice which exceeds all calculation, all possibility, and all work. This second demand is what specifically requires the community to look beyond all forms of self-identity or self-presence in order to assume an impossible responsibility for the nameless other, without identification, and without resources, who is always yet to come. Such is the challenge, as daunting as it is urgent, that is inseparable from Blanchot’s later thought.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Major Works

Thomas l’Obscur, Gallimard, Paris, Gallimard, 2005.
Aminadab, Paris, Gallimard, 1942.
Faux Pas, Paris, Gallimard, 1943.
Le Très-Haut, Paris, Gallimard, 1948.
L’Arrêt de mort, Paris, Gallimard, 1948.
La Part du feu, Paris, Gallimard, 1949.
Lautréamont et Sade, Paris, Minuit, 1949.
Au moment voulu, Paris, Gallimard, 1951.
Celui qui ne m’accompagnait pas, Paris, Gallimard, 1953.
L’Espace littéraire, Paris, Gallimard, 1955.
Le Dernier Homme, Paris, Gallimard, 1957.
Le Livre à venir, Paris, Gallimard, 1959.
L’Attente L’Oubli, Paris, Gallimard, 1962.
L’Entretien infini, Paris, Gallimard, 1969.
L’Amitié, Paris, Gallimard, 1971.
La Folie du jour, Montpellier, Fata Morgana, 1973.
Le Pas au-delà, Paris, Gallimard, 1973.
L’Écriture du désastre, Paris, Gallimard, 1980.
La Communauté inavouable, Paris, Minuit, 1983.
Michel Foucault tel que je l’imagine, Montpellier, Fata Morgana, 1986.
Une voix venue d’ailleurs : Sur les poèmes de Louis-René des Forêts, Plombières-les-Dijon, Ulysse, Fin de Siècle, 1992.
L’Instant de ma mort, Montpellier, Fata Morgana, 1994.
Écrits politiques 1958-1993, Paris, Lignes-éditions Léo Scheer, 2003.

b. English Translations

Death Sentence (1978). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Gaze of Orpheus and Other Literary Essays (1981). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Madness of the Day (1981). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Sirens’ Song (1982). Brighton: Harvester.
The Space of Literature (1982). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
Vicious Circles, followed by ‘After the Fact’ (1985). New York: Station Hill Press.
When the Time Comes (1985). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Writing of the Disaster (1986). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
The Last Man (1987). New York: Columbia University Press.
Michel Foucault as I Imagine Him in Foucault/Blanchot (1987). New York: Zone Books.
Thomas the Obscure (1988). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Unavowable Community (1988). New York: Station Hill Press.
The One Who Was Standing Apart From Me (1992). New York: Station Hill Press.
The Step Not Beyond (1992). Albany: State University of New York Press.
The Infinite Conversation (1993). Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1993.
The Blanchot Reader (1995). Oxford: Blackwell.
The Most High (1995). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
The Work of Fire (1995). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Awaiting Oblivion (1997). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
Friendship (1997). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
The Station Hill Blanchot Reader (1998). New York: Station Hill Press.
‘The Instant of My Death’ in Maurice Blanchot and Jacques Derrida, The Instant of My Death / Demeure: Fiction and Testimony (2000). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Faux Pas (2001). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Aminadab (2002). Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
The Book to Come (2003). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Lautréamont and Sade (2004). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
A Voice from Elsewhere (2007). Albany: State University of New York Press.
Political Writings, 1953-1993 (2010). New York: Fordham University Press.

c. Secondary Bibliography

Bident C., Maurice Blanchot, partenaire invisible, Paris, Champ Vallon, 1998.
Bruns G., Maurice Blanchot: The Refusal of Philosophy, Baltimore, Johns Hopkins Press, 1997.
Collin F., Maurice Blanchot et la question de l’écriture, Paris, Gallimard, 1971.
Derrida J., Parages, Paris, Galilée, 1986.
Fort J., The Imperative to Write: Destitutions of the Sublime in Kafka, Blanchot and Beckett, New York, Fordham University Press, 2014.
Fynsk C., Last Step: Maurice Blanchot’s Exilic Writings, New York, Fordham University Press, 2013.
Hart K., The Dark Gaze: Maurice Blanchot and the Sacred, Chicago, University of Chicago Press, 2004.
Hewson M., Blanchot and Literary Criticism, London, Bloomsbury Academic, 2011.
Hill L., Blanchot: Extreme Contemporary, London, Routledge, 1997.
Hill L., Maurice Blanchot and Fragmentary Writing: A Change of Epoch, London, Continuum, 2012.
Holland M., Avant dire: essais sur Blanchot, Paris, Hermann, 2015.
Iyer L., Blanchot’s Communism, London, Palgrave Macmillan, 2004.
Kuzma J., The Eroticization of Distance: Nietzsche, Blanchot, and the Legacy of Courtly Love, Lanham, Lexington, 2016.
Lacoue-Labarthe, P., Agonie terminée, agonie interminable: Sur Maurice Blanchot, Paris, Galilée, 2011.
Nancy J., The Disavowed Community, New York, Fordham University Press, 2016.
Nancy J., Maurice Blanchot, passion politique, Paris, Galilée, 2011.

Author Information

Joseph Kuzma
Email: jkuzma@uccs.edu
University of Colorado, Colorado Springs
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy