Jürgen Habermas (1929—)

Jürgen Habermas produced a large body of work over more than five decades. His early work was devoted to the public sphere, to modernization, and to critiques of trends in philosophy and politics. He then slowly began to articulate theories of rationality, meaning, and truth. His two-volume Theory of Communicative Action in 1981 revised and systematized many of these ideas, and inaugurated his mature thought. Afterward, he turned his attention to ethics and democratic theory. He linked theory and practice by engaging work in other disciplines and speaking as a public intellectual. Given the wide scope of his work, it is useful to identify a few enduring themes.

Habermas represents the second generation of Frankfurt School Critical Theory. His mature work started a “communicative turn” in Critical Theory. This turn contrasted with the approaches of his mentors, Max Horkheimer and Theodor W. Adorno, who were among the founders of Critical Theory. Habermas sees this turn as a paradigm shift away from many assumptions within traditional ontological approaches of ancient philosophy as well as what he calls the “philosophy of the subject” that characterized the early modern period. He has instead tried to build a “post-metaphysical” and linguistically oriented approach to philosophical research.

Another contrast with early Critical Theory is that Habermas defends the “unfinished” emancipatory project of the Enlightenment against various critiques. One such critique arose when the moral catastrophe of WWII shattered hopes that modernity’s increasing rationalization and technological innovation would yield human emancipation. Habermas argued that a picture of Enlightenment rationality wedded to domination only arises if we conflate instrumental rationality with rationality as such—if technical control is mistaken for the entirety of communication. He subsequently developed an account of “communicative rationality” oriented around achieving mutual understandings rather than simply success or authenticity.

Another enduring theme in Habermas’ work is his defense of “post-national” structures of political self-determination and transnational governance against more traditional models of the nation-state. He sees traditional notions of national identity as declining in importance; and the world, as faced with problems stemming from interdependency that can no longer be addressed at the national level. Instead of national identity centered on shared historical traditions, ethnic belonging, or national culture, he advocates a “constitutional patriotism” where political commitment, collective identity, and allegiance coalesce around the shared principles and procedures of a liberal democratic constitutionalism facilitating public discourse and self-determination. Habermas also claims that emerging structures of international law and transnational governance represent generally positive achievements moving the global political order in a cosmopolitan direction that better protects human rights and fosters the spread of democratic norms. He sees the emergence of the European Union as paradigmatic in this regard. However, his cosmopolitanism should not be overstated. He does not advocate global democracy in any strong sense, and he is committed to the idea that democratic self-determination requires a measure of localized mutual identification in the form of civic solidarity—a legally mediated solidarity around shared history, institutions, and rooted in some shared “ethical” pattern of life (see Sittlichkeit discussion below) fostering mutual understandings.

Table of Contents

1. Biography: Early Life to Structural Transformation
2. Enduring Themes in Formative and Transitional Work
   1. Public Deliberation Over Positivist Decisionism and Technocracy
   2. From Philosophical Anthropology to a Theory of Social Evolution
3. The Linguistic Turn into the Theory of Communicative Action
4. Discourse Ethics
5. Political and Legal Theory
6. References and Further Reading
   1. General Introductions to Habermas
   2. Introductory Books and Articles on Specific Themes
      1. Biography
      2. Linguistic Turn
      3. Discourse Ethics
      4. Political Theory
   3. Works Cited
   4. Secondary Scholarship Beyond the Subject-Specific Recommendations Cited Above

1. Biography: Early Life to Structural Transformation

Habermas was born in 1929 in Düsseldorf, Germany. He has noted that early corrective surgeries for a cleft palate sensitized him to human vulnerability and interdependence, and that subsequent childhood struggles with fluid verbal communication may partly explain his theoretical interest in communication and mutual recognition. He has also cited the end of WWII and frustrations over postwar Germany’s uneven willingness to fully break with its past as key personal experiences that inform his political theory.

Habermas belongs to what historians call the “Flakhelfer generation” or the “forty-fivers.” Flakhelfer means antiaircraft-assistant. At the end of the war, people born between 1926 and 1929 were drafted and sent to help man antiaircraft artillery defenses. Over a million youth served as such personnel. The second “forty-fiver” label captures how this generation came of age with the 1945 Nazi defeat. These experiences fostered a political skepticism and vigilance born out of having been exploited, and an affinity for the nascent liberal democratic principles of postwar Germany. Both labels capture formative features of Habermas’ biography (Specter 2010, Matustik 2001).

Reflecting on his upbringing during the war, Habermas describes his family as having passively adapted to the Nazi regime—neither identifying with nor opposing it. He was recruited into the Hitler Youth in 1944 and sent to man defenses on the western front shortly before the war ended. Soon thereafter he learned of the Nazi atrocities through radio broadcasts of the Nuremburg trials and concentration camp documentaries at local theaters. Such experiences left a deep impact: “all at once we saw that we had been living in a politically criminal system” (AS 77, 43, 231).

After the war, he studied philosophy at the universities of Göttingen (1949-50), Zurich (50-51) and Bonn (51-54). He wrote his thesis on Schelling under the direction of Erich Rothacker and Oskar Becker. He was increasingly frustrated with the unwillingness of German politicians and academics to own up to their role in the war. He was disappointed in the postwar government’s failure to make a fresh political start and distressed by continuities with the past. In interviews, he has recalled leaving a campaign rally in 1949 after being disgusted by the far-right connotations of the flags and songs used. He was similarly disappointed by German academics. At university he studied the work of Arnold Gehlen and Martin Heidegger extensively, but their prior Nazi ties were not discussed openly. In 1953 Heidegger reissued his 1935 Lectures on Metaphysics in a largely unedited form that included reference to the “inner truth and greatness of the Nazi movement.” Habermas published an op-ed challenging Heidegger, and the lack of response seemed to confirm his suspicions (NC, 140-172). He wrote a piece critiquing Gehlen a few years later (1956). Around the same time he was distressed to learn Rothacker and Becker had also been active Nazi party members.

Near the end of his studies Habermas worked as a freelance journalist and published essays in the intellectual journal Merkur. He took an interest in the interdisciplinary Institute for Social Research affiliated with the University of Frankfurt. The Institute had returned from wartime exile in 1950, and Adorno became director in 1955. Adorno was familiar with Habermas’ essays and took him on as a research assistant. While at the Institute Habermas studied philosophy and sociology, worked on research projects, and continued to publish op-ed pieces. One such piece, Marx and Marxism, struck Horkheimer as too radical. Horkheimer wrote to Adorno suggesting he dismiss Habermas from the Institute. The following year Horkheimer rejected Habermas’ Habilitationsschrift proposal on the public sphere. Habermas did not want to alter his project, so he completed his dissertation at the University of Marburg under the Marxist political scientist Wolfgang Abendroth.

His Habilitationsschrift, The Structural Transformation of the Public Sphere (German 1962, English 1989), was well received in Germany. It chronicled the rise of the bourgeois public sphere in 18^th and 19^th century Europe, as well as its decline amidst the mass consumer capitalism of the 20^th century. Habermas gave an account of the way in which newspapers, coffee shops, literary journals, pubs, public meetings, parliament and other public forums facilitated the emergence of powerful new social norms of discourse and debate that mediated between private interests and the public good. These forums functioned as mechanisms to disseminate information and help freely form the public political will needed for collective self-determination. These norms also partly embodied important principles like equality, solidarity, and liberty. By the late 19^th century, however, capitalism was increasingly monopolistic. Large corporations easily influenced the state and society. Economic elites could use ownership of the media and other (previously public) forums to manipulate or manufacture public opinion and buy-off politicians. Citizens deliberating about the common good were transformed into atomized consumers pursuing private interests. Habermas describes this as the “re-feudalization” of the public sphere. While his narrative was pessimistic, the end of Structural Transformation seems to hold out hope that the truncated normative potential of the public sphere may yet be revived. The work solidified Habermas’ place in the German academy. After a short stint in Heidelberg, he returned to the University of Frankfurt in 1964 as a professor of philosophy and sociology, taking over the chair vacated by Horkheimer’s retirement.

In the spirit of his early call for renewed public sphere debate, Habermas has consistently engaged political movements as a public intellectual and taken part in various scholarly debates. This has not always been easy. After returning to Frankfurt he had been a mentor for the German student movement, but had a falling out with student radicals in 1967. In June of that year a variety of simmering protests—over the restructuring of German universities, proposed “emergency laws,” the Vietnam War, and other issues—boiled over. The breaking point was when a student at a protest against the Shah of Iran was shot and fatally beaten by plainclothes police, who then tried to cover up the incident. This stoked the flames of student protests. Sit-ins and protests crippled everyday life. Under the leadership of Rudi Dutschke students occupied the Free University of Berlin.

Habermas worried that protest leaders seemed to be advocating an unsophisticated and extra-legal opposition to any and all authority that could easily lead to violence. At a conference in Hannover shortly after the shooting he publically reproached Dutschke by calling his model of extra-legal direct-action “left fascism.” That charge alienated Habermas from the leftist student movement and inspired an essay collection Die Linke antwortet Jürgen Habermas (The Left Answers Habermas—German 1969). Rapprochement would only come a decade later when, in the aftermath of a series of killings by the radical left-wing Red Army Faction, politicians on the right tried to garner political capital by suggesting that such terrorism was rooted in the ideas of Frankfurt School Critical Theory. Habermas and Dutschke published pieces repudiating the accusation. A decade later, the editor of the essay collection apologized for how the book made it seem like Habermas’ falling out with the student movement marked a conservative turn that meant he was no longer part of the left.

As a public intellectual, Habermas has engaged a variety of topics: the anti-nuclear movement of the late fifties, the “Euromissile” debate of the early eighties and, in the early two-thousands, both the terrorism of 9/11 and the second Iraq War. In the second half of the eighties he was also a key voice in the Historikerstreit debate between historians, philosophers, and other academics about the proper way for Germany to situate and remember the Holocaust amidst the history of other atrocities. In 1989 he made important contributions to public debate about the reunification of Germany. While Habermas was not against reunification, he was critical of the speed and manner in which reunification was carried out. More recently, he has approached public debate on the European Union along the broadly similar lines of a cautious optimism that is also on guard against a forced, rushed, or duped false unity that would lack legitimacy and stability over the long term.

In a more academic vein, he has had numerous exchanges with thinkers like Jacques Derrida, Richard Rorty, Hans-Georg Gadamer, Niklas Luhmann, John Rawls, Robert Brandom, Hilary Putnam, and Cardinal Joseph Ratzinger (before he was Pope Benedict XVI). His ongoing debate with postmodernism is arguably the most enduring line of debate. Broadly speaking, thinkers like Michel Foucault, Jacques Derrida, and Richard Rorty have levied criticisms to the effect that reason is little more than a historically and culturally contingent social form, that notions of universally valid morality and truth are ethnocentric projections of power, that interests shaped by radically different ways of life are irreconcilable, and that our belief in the emancipatory moral progress of humankind is a myth. Habermas has tried to meet such challenges in much the same way as he responded to Horkheimer and Adorno’s Dialectic of Enlightenment: by relying on his account of communicative rationality in Theory of Communicative Action. However, before turning to that more mature theory, we must survey a few major phases of his formative and transitional work.

2. Enduring Themes in Formative and Transitional Work

a. Public Deliberation Over Positivist Decisionism and Technocracy

The essays in Towards a Rational Society (German 1968 and 1969, English 1970) and Theory and Practice (German 1971, English 1973b) were written on the heels of Structural Transformation. They were written amidst the “positivism dispute” in Germany about the relation between the natural and social sciences. The (somewhat inaccurately labeled) “positivist” side of this debate took scientific inquiry as the sole paradigm of knowledge and generally thought of the social sciences as analogous to the natural sciences. Following Adorno, Habermas argued against a positivistic understanding of the social sciences.

For Habermas, positivism is comprised of three claims: (1) knowledge consists of causal explanations cast in terms of basic laws or principles (for example, laws of nature), (2) knowledge passively reflects or mirrors independently existing natural facts, (3) knowledge is about what is, not what ought to be. He calls these claims scientism, objectivism, and value-neutrality. He said each can be pernicious, especially in the social scientific realm. Scientism fosters the view that only causal and empirically verifiable hypotheses can count as true knowledge. Objectivism seems to falsely naturalize the world by ignoring how lived experiences, human subjectivity, and interests can structure the object domain that gets identified as relevant or worthy of study. Lastly, value-neutrality misleads us into thinking that the role of knowledge is purely descriptive and technical. Values or preferences are seen as separate from knowledge and, as such, wholly subjective “givens” lying beyond rational justification. In turn, knowledge is seen as a tool for efficiently controlling the environment so as to realize whatever values an agent happens to hold. Ironically, this fails to see the tacit value commitments already inscribed in this general paradigm of knowledge.

Habermas’ critique makes sense given his place in Frankfurt Critical Theory. Despite differences with the first generation, he shares the decidedly non-neutral commitments to human emancipation, interdisciplinarity, and self-reflexive theory. Like Horkheimer and Adorno, Habermas worried the prior ascendancy of positivism had left influences on our conceptualizations of knowledge and social inquiry that were hard for even reflective positivists to leave behind. Indeed, he critiques Karl R. Popper’s account of inquiry and knowledge even though it rejects what Habermas calls objectivism. In opposition to a positivist picture of knowledge merely mirroring the world, Habermas holds the Frankfurt School’s Hegelian-Marxist-inspired conception of a dialectical relation between knowledge and world. Finally, like his Frankfurt School contemporaries, Habermas was concerned that positivism had left subtle yet pernicious impacts on politics.

In early writings Habermas is especially critical of two related trends, decisionism and technocracy, that stem from a positivistic understanding of political science and practice. Decisionism starts from the assumption that there is no such thing as the public interest, but rather a clash of inherently subjective values that do not (even in principle) admit of rational persuasion or agreement. It follows that political elites must either simply decide between competing values or base policy on their aggregation. Either way, political value preferences are taken as brute or static facts; there is no sense in which reasoned argumentation and persuasion could genuinely transform such preferences or lead people to a new understanding of their values. Technocracy builds from this point by emphasizing the “objective necessities” (Sachzwänge) supposedly involved in a political system—economic growth, social stability, national security—and highlighting the increasing ability of policy experts to advise political leaders about strategies for optimally realizing these goals. The worry with this approach is that questions about what specific type of growth, stability, and security we seek (and why) are removed from debate by definitional fiat. In decisionism, political legitimacy flows from periodic expressions of acclamation or disapproval at the way leaders have manifested predefined values. In technocracy, legitimacy supposedly flows from the ability of politicians to find and follow expert advice so as to attain fixed outcomes pre-defined by “objective necessities.” Both models render the potentially transformative effects of public deliberation superfluous. Legitimacy is seen as flowing from either certain outcomes or periodic expressions of aggregate preference.

Habermas thinks both models are extremely problematic accounts of democratic political practice and legitimacy. While Structural Transformation only gestured at how the normative potential of the public sphere could be reinvigorated in contemporary circumstances, this theme received increasing attention in works such as Legitimation Crisis (German 1973, English 1975), Theory of Communicative Action, and Between Facts and Norms (German 1992, English 1996). An account of democratic legitimacy that combats decisionism and technocracy is an enduring concern. Indeed, despite championing the European Union he has continued to critique technocracy by criticizing the way in which it has arisen and is currently structured (2008, 2009, 2012, 2014).

b. From Philosophical Anthropology to a Theory of Social Evolution

Knowledge and Human Interests (German 1968, English 1971) and Communication and the Evolution of Society (German 1976, English 1979) are two early attempts at a new systematic framework for Critical Theory. The approaches he uses are akin to the tradition of “philosophical anthropology” in the German social theory of the early 1900s that grew out of phenomenology—a tradition that is quite different from contemporary anthropology. Knowledge and Human Interests sought to overcome positivist epistemology that saw knowledge as simply discerning static facts, and to give a plausible account of the dialectical relation between knowledge (theory) and world (practice). Habermas’ main claim was that the knowledge of scientific and social progress is tacitly guided by three types of “knowledge constitutive interests”—technical, practical, and emancipatory—that are “anthropologically deep-seated” in the human species.

Knowledge and Human Interests tries to recover and develop alternative models of the relation between theory and practice. The approach is historical and reconstructive in that it interprets the attempts of prior theorists as part of a trajectory that Habermas wants to extend. He reviews prior reformulations of Kant’s “transcendental synthesis” (the form-legislating activity making objective experience possible) and his “transcendental unity of apperception” (the unity of the subject having such experience). He also tries to articulate the way in which Hegel relocated such synthesis in the historical development of human subjectivity (absolute spirit) and how Marx relocated it in the material use of tools and techniques (embodied labor). Habermas wants to add to such a trajectory by rehabilitating their shared insight that the constitution of experience is not generated by transcendental operations but by the worldly natural activities of the human species. Yet he wants to do this in a way that avoids the mistakes of Marx and Hegel as well. He tries to do this by building on his interpretation of Hegel, which was already concisely captured by his essay Science and Technology as Ideology (German 1968, included in English 1970).

In that essay he responded to Herbert Marcuse’s claim that the technical reason of science inherently embodies domination. According to Marcuse, under late capitalism the technical reason of science functions ideologically to collapse intersubjective practical questions about how we want to live together into technical questions about how to control the world to get what we want. Habermas shares Marcuse’s concerns, as his criticism of technocracy makes clear. Yet he thinks this dynamic is contingent because, taken as an emergent collective project, humankind constitutes how the world shows up in experience through its worldly activity. More specifically, Habermas identifies two irreducibly distinct and dialectically related modes of human self-formation, “labor” and “interaction.” Whereas labor is an action type that aims at technical control to achieve success, interaction is an action type that aims at mutual understandings embodied in consensual norms. Marcuse’s claim (and his remedy of a “new science”) would only stand if the “interaction” of intersubjective collective political choice—including the question of how we use technology—was somehow subsumed or rendered superfluous by the “labor” of technological progress in controlling the external world. But, given Habermas’ views in this period, this is impossible. Interaction and labor seem to be pitched as irreducible and invariant categories of human experience. Neither can be dropped nor can one be subsumed in the other—even if their relation becomes unbalanced.

In Knowledge and Human Interests, this division between labor and interaction is recast as the technical and practical interests of humankind. The technical interest is in the material reproduction of the species through labor on nature. Humans use tools and technologies to manage nature for material accommodation. The practical interest is in the social reproduction of human communities through intersubjective norms of culture and communication. Human social life requires members who can understand each other, share expectations, and achieve cooperation. In a sense, these interests are the “most fundamental.” Moreover, the knowledge that flows from them is supposed to slowly accrue over time in the enduring institutions of society: theoretical knowledge driven by the technical interest in controlling nature accrues in the “empirical-analytic” sciences, and normative knowledge driven by the practical interest in mutual understandings accrues in the interpretive “historical-hermeneutic” sciences.

But, going beyond Science and Technology as Ideology, in Knowledge and Human Interests Habermas adds a third “emancipatory” human interest in freedom and autonomy. The labor of material reproduction and the interaction norms of social reproduction require, in a weak sense, psychosocial mechanisms to repress or deny basic drives and impulses that would destroy material and social reproduction. For instance, labor requires delayed gratification and social interaction requires internalized notions of obligation, reciprocity, shame, guilt, and so forth. Unfortunately, psychosocial mechanisms of control are often used far more than they need to be to secure material and social reproduction. Indeed, perverse incentives to rely on such mechanisms may even arise: if the burdens and benefits of material and social reproduction processes become unfairly distributed across groups and solidified over time, then those in power may find psychosocial mechanisms useful. If women are falsely taught there are natural laws of gender relations such that the dominant patterns of marriage and domestic work that consistently disadvantage them are the best they can hope for, this is an ideological mechanism of social control. It is the limitation of freedom and autonomy for no purpose other than domination, and it “functions” through systematically distorted communication.

Habermas posits a human interest in using self-reflection and insight to combat ideologically veiled, superfluous social domination so as to realize freedom and autonomy. While there is no clearly institutionalized set of sciences where the knowledge spurred on by such an interest would accrue, Habermas points to Marx’s critique of ideology and Freud’s psychoanalytic dissolution of repression as demonstrating a cognitive viewpoint that focuses on neither (efficient) work nor (legitimate) interaction but (free) identity formation liberated from internalized systematically distorted communication. Here Habermas takes his lead from Kant’s idea that reason aims to emancipate itself from “self-incurred tutelage,” and tries to forge a link between theory (reason) and practice (in the sense of self-realization) through using critical reflection on self and society to unveil and dissolve internalized oppressive power structures that betray one’s own true interests.

Knowledge and Human Interests was envisioned as a preface for two other books that would jointly challenge the separation of theory and practice. However, the project was never finished. On the one hand, Habermas felt that vibrant critiques of positivism in the philosophy of science made the rest of the project superfluous. On the other, the work encountered heavy criticism. For starters, Habermas seems to pitch work and interaction as real action types. But, if we account for how work is communicatively structured, interaction is teleologically ordered, and how historical notions of work and interaction structure one’s sense of freedom, then it is clear these can be at best idealizations. Moreover, as even sympathetic interpreters noted, his account of an emancipatory interest seemed to blur together reflection on “general presuppositions and conditions of valid knowledge and action” with “reflection on the specific formative history of a particular individual or group” (Giddens, McCarthy, 95). Lastly, his stipulation of knowledge-constitutive interests seemed to reproduce the sort of foundationalism he wished to avoid.

Given such criticism, it may seem surprising that Communication and the Evolution of Society reconstructs Marx’s historical materialism as a theory of social evolution. This sounds foundationalist and deterministically teleological. These impressions are misleading. Around this time Habermas began presenting his work as a “research program” with tentative and fallible claims evaluable by theoretical discourses. Moreover, while he speaks of evolution, he uses the term differently than 19^th century philosophies of history (Hegel, Marx, Spencer) or later Darwinian accounts. His “social evolution” is neither a merely path-dependent accumulative directionality nor a progressive, strongly teleological realization of an ideal goal. Instead, he envisions a society’s latent potentials as tending to unfold according to an immanent developmental logic similar to the developmental logic cognitive-developmental psychologists claim maturing people normally follow. Lastly, Habermas’ theory of social evolution avoids worries about determinism by distinguishing between the logic and the mechanisms of development such that evolution is neither inevitable, linear, irreversible, nor continuous. A brief sketch of his theory follows.

Habermas characterizes human society as a system that integrates material production (work) and normative socialization (interaction) processes through linguistically coordinated action. This is qualitatively different from the static and transitive status hierarchy systems of even other “social” animals. In various human epochs the linguistic coordination of these processes crystalizes around different “organizational principles” that are the “institutional nucleus” of social integration. In the most basic societies kinship structures play this role by (to take just one possible configuration) dividing labor and specifying socialization responsibilities through sex-based roles and norms. Habermas claims this organizational principle was replaced by political order in traditional societies and the economy in liberal capitalist societies. Social evolution in general and the particular movements from one “nucleus” to the next stem from learning in material and social reproduction.

Understood as ideal types, work and interaction mark out different ways of relating to the world. On the one hand, in material production one mainly adopts an instrumental perspective that tries to control an object in conformity to one’s will. In this orientation, learning is gauged by success in controlling the world and the resultant knowledge is cognitive-technical. On the other, in social reproduction one mainly adopts a communicative perspective that tries to coordinate actions and expectations through consensually agreed upon normative standards. In this orientation learning is gauged by mutual understanding and the resultant knowledge is moral-practical. Each learning process follows its own logic. But, since the processes are integrated in the same social system, advances in either type of knowledge can yield internal tensions or incongruities. These cannot be suppressed by force or ideology for long, and eventually need to be solved by more learning or innovation. If these internal tensions are too great, they induce a crisis requiring an entirely new “institutional nucleus.”

For Habermas, the slow social learning in history is the sedimentation of iterated processes of individual learning that accumulates in social institutions. While there is no unified macro-subject that learns, social evolution is also not mere happenstance plus inertia. It is the indirect outcome of individual learning processes, and such processes unfold with a developmental logic or deep structure of learning: “the fundamental mechanism for social evolution in general is to be found in an automatic inability not to learn. Not learning but not-learning is the phenomenon that calls for explanation” (LC, 15; also see Rapic 2014, 68). Habermas posits a universal developmental logic that tends to guide individual learning and maturation in technical-instrumental and moral-practical knowledge. He discerns this logic in the complementary research of Jean Piaget in cognitive development and Lawrence Kohlberg in the development of moral judgment. As social and individual learning are linked, such underlying logic has slowly created homologies—similarities in sequence and form—between: (i.) individual ego-development and group identity, (ii.) individual ego-development and world-perspectives, and (iii.) the individual ego-development of moral judgment and the structures of law and morality (Owen 2002, 132). Habermas pays more attention to the last homology and later writings focus on Kohlberg, so it is instructive to focus there (1990b).

Kohlberg’s research on how children typically develop moral judgment yielded a schema of three levels (pre-conventional, conventional, and post-conventional) and six stages (punishment-obedience, instrumental-hedonism/relativism, “good-boy-nice-girl”, legalistic social-contract/law-and-order, universal ethical principles). Two stages correspond to each level. Habermas follows Kohlberg’s three levels in claiming we can retrospectively discern pre-conventional, conventional, and post-conventional phases through which societies have historically developed. Just as normal individuals who progress from child to adult pass through levels where different types of reasons are taken to be acceptable for action and judgment, so too we can retrospectively look at the development of social integration mechanisms in societies as having been achieved in progressive phases where legal and moral institutions were structured by underlying organizational principles.

Habermas slightly diverges from the six stages of Kohlberg’s schema by proposing a schema of neolithic societies, archaic civilizations, developed civilizations, and early modern societies. Neolithic societies organized interaction via kinship and mythical worldviews. They also resolved conflicts via feuds appealing to an authority to mediate disputes in a pre-conventional way to restore the status quo. Archaic civilizations organized interaction via hierarchies beyond kinship and tailored mythical worldviews backing such hierarchies. Conflicts started to be resolved via mediation appealing to an authority relying on more abstract ideas of justice—punishment instead of retaliation, assessment of intentions, and so forth. Developed civilizations still organized interaction conventionally, but adopted a rationalized worldview with post-conventional moral elements. This allowed conflicts to be mediated by a type of law that, while rooted in a community’s (conventional) moral framework, was separable from the authority administering it. Finally, with early modern societies, we find certain domains of interaction are post-conventionally structured. Moreover, a sharper divide between morality and legality emerges such that conflicts can be legally regulated without presupposing shared morality or needing to rely on the cohering force of mythical worldviews backing hierarchies (McCarthy 1978, 252).

Obviously, this sketch is rather vague and needs further elaboration. This is especially true in light of the ways a superficial reading (that takes social evolution as strictly parallel rather than homologous to individual development) lends itself to unsavory developmentalist narratives. Yet, apart from a few later writings, Habermas has not returned to his theory of social evolution in a systematic way. Several secondary authors have tried to fill in the details (Rockmore 1989, Owen 2002, Brunkhorst 2014, Rapic 2014). Nevertheless, Habermas still endorses the contours of his theory of social evolution: these ideas show up in Theory of Communicative Action and his later writings on the nature and development of legality and democratic legitimacy bear a loose connection to this early work (especially the final homology above) insofar as they are tailored for specifically post-conventional societies. Yet, before turning to his democratic theory, we must tackle the hugely important intervening body of work concerning his communicative turn and its articulation in his Theory of Communicative Action.

3. The Linguistic Turn into the Theory of Communicative Action

Habermas’ engagement with speech act theory and hermeneutics in the late 1960s and 70s started a linguistic turn that came to full fruition in Theory of Communicative Action. This turn makes sense after both Knowledge and Human Interests and Communication and the Evolution of Society. He came to see the knowledge-constitutive interests of the former as illicitly relying on assumptions in the philosophy of consciousness and Kantian transcendentalism, while the reconstructed phases of social learning and evolution in the latter can seem far too naturalistic or foundationalist. In contrast, a focus on communicative structures let him form his own pragmatic theory of meaning, rationality, and social integration based in reconstructions of the competencies and normative presuppositions underlying communication. This approach is transcendental and naturalistic but only weakly so. Far from an account of ultimate foundations, his approach takes itself to be a post-metaphysical methodology for philosophical and social scientific research into practical reason. From the start of his linguistic turn until well after Theory of Communicative Action this approach underwent revisions. In what follows, only a broad outline of this trajectory is given.

Habermas has cited his 1971 Gauss lectures at Princeton (German publication 1984b, English publication 2001) as the first clear expression of the linguistic turn, but it was also evident in On the Logic of the Social Sciences (German 1967, English 1988a). His first truly systematic foray in Anglo-American philosophy of language came with What is Universal Pragmatics? (German 1976b, included in English 1979). His ideas were then revised further in Theory of Communicative Action. While the development of his ideas throughout this period is an important exegetical task, for present purposes the broad way he takes up speech act theory is what is important: he accepts the division in linguistics between syntax, semantics, and pragmatics. He considers each division to be reconstructing the tacit system of rules used by competent speakers to recognize the well-formed-ness (syntax), meaningfulness (semantics), and success (pragmatics) of speech. His main interpretive twist is that the theories of truth-conditional propositional meaning often associated with philosophical projects regarding language only locate part of the meaning of speech. Thus, he moves away from meaning based on the correspondence theory of truth and gives an account of the unique pragmatic validity behind the meaning of speech.

While his linguistic turn is sometimes cast as a break with prior theory, his interpretive approach actually coheres quite well with his early critique of positivism. He has always rejected the idea that language simply states things about the world. Instead of merely analyzing propositions that either do (true) or do not (false) obtain in the world, he is interested in the full range of ways people use language. He claims that, instead of focusing on sentences, a complete theory of language would focus on contextual utterances as the most basic unit of meaning. Thus, he developed a formal pragmatics (called “universal pragmatics” in early work). Building on the work of Karl Bühler, he conceives of the pragmatic use of language in context as embedding sentences in relations between speaker, hearer, and the world. This embedding helps to intersubjectively stabilize such relations. Habermas claims that, in uttering a speech act speakers mean something (express subjective intentions), do something (interact with or appeal to a hearer) and say something (cognitively represent the world). While truth-conditional theories of meaning focus on cognitive representations of the world, Habermas prioritizes the pragmatics of speech acts over the semantic or syntactical analysis of sentences. What is done through speech is taken to be what is most basic for meaning.

During his linguistic turn Habermas appropriated several ideas from John Searle. Even though Searle has not always fully agreed with such appropriations, two of them are useful points of orientation (Searle 2010, 62). Habermas adopts Searle’s idea of the constitutive rules underlying language: just like the rules of a game define what counts as a legitimate move or status, so too there is an implicit rule-governed structure to the use of language by competent speakers. He also adopts Searle’s view, built on JL Austin’s work, that speech has a double structure of both propositional content and illocutionary force. For instance, the propositional content of “it is snowy in Chicago” is a representation of the world. But the same content can be used in different illocutionary modes: as a warning to drive carefully, as a plea to delay travel, as a question or answer in a larger conversation, and so on. Moreover, beyond such illocutionary force, all speech acts also have derivative perlocutionary effects that, unlike illocution, are not internally connected to the meaning of what is said. A warning about snow may elicit annoyance or gratitude, but such responses are contextually inferred and not necessarily connected to either the propositional content or the warning itself.

These ideas about the structure of speech highlight a few key points. First, Habermas takes perlocutionary success (for example, eliciting gratitude) to be parasitic on illocutionary force (for example, the speech is perceived as a warning, not a plea). Attaining success with others by realizing one’s intention in the world is secondary to achieving an understanding with them. For example, even when lying, the lie only works by first coming to a false understanding that what is being said is true. Second, he identifies three modes of communication—cognitive, interactive, and expressive—that depend on whether a speaker’s main illocutionary intention is to raise a truth claim of propositional content, a claim of rightness for an act, or a claim of sincerity about psychological states. Third, he identifies corresponding speech act types—constatives, regulatives, and expressives—that, seen from the perspective of a competent language user, contain immanent obligations to redeem the aforementioned claims by respectively providing grounds, articulating justifications, or proving sincerity and trustworthiness.

In short, Habermas thinks there are general presuppositions of communicative competence and possible understanding that underlie speech and which require speakers to take responsibility for the “fit” between an utterance and inner, outer, and social worlds. For any speech act oriented towards mutual understanding, there is a presumed fit of sincerity to the speaker’s inner world, truth to the outer world, and rightness to what is inter-subjectively done in the social world. Naturally, these presumptions are defeasible. Yet, the point is that speakers who want to reach an agreement have to presuppose sincerity, truth and rightness so as to be able to mutually accept something as a fact, valid norm, or subjectively held experience.

For Habermas these elements form the “validity basis of speech.” He claims that, by uttering a speech act, a speaker is seen as also potentially raising three “validity claims”: sincerity for what is expressed, rightness for what is done, and truth for what is said or presupposed. Depending on the speech act type, one claim often predominates (for example, constatives raise a validity claim of truth) and, more often than not, speech rests on undisturbed background agreements about facts, norms, and experiences. Moreover, minor disagreement can be quickly resolved through clarifying meaning, reminding others of facts, asking about preexisting commitments, highlighting situational features, and so on. Habermas sometimes refers to such minor communicative repairs as “everyday speech.” But when disagreement persists we may need to transition to what Habermas calls “discourse”: a particular mode of communication in which a hearer asks for reasons that would back up a speaker’s validity claim. In discourse the validity claims that are always immanent within speech become explicit.

Clearly, Habermas uses “validity” in an odd way. The notion of validity is most often used in formal logic where it refers to the preservation of truth when inferentially moving from one proposition to another in an argument. This is not how Habermas uses the term. What then does he mean by validity? It is instructive to look at the assumptions behind his theory of meaning. When his model of meaning emphasizes what language does over what it merely says or means the operative assumption is that the primary function of speech is to arrive at mutual understandings enabling conflict-free interaction. Moreover, at least with respect to claims of truth and rightness, he assumes genuine and stable understandings arise out of the give and take of reasons. Claims of truth and rightness are paradigmatically cognitive in that they admit of justification through reasons offered in discourse. What Habermas means by validity then is a close structural relationship between the give and take of reasons and either achieving an understanding or (more strongly) a consensus that allows for conflict-free interaction. This yields an “acceptability theory” of meaning where the acceptance of norms is always open to further debate and refinement through better reasons.

As we cannot know in advance what reasons will bear on a given issue, only robust and open discourses license us to take the (provisional) consensuses we do achieve as valid. Habermas therefore formulates formal and counterfactual conditions—the “pragmatic presuppositions” of speech and the “ideal speech situation”—that describe and set standards for the type of reason-giving that mutual understandings must pass through before we can regard them as valid (on these formal conditions and how understanding and consensus may differ see below and section 4). At the same time, we never start this give-and-take of reasons from scratch. People are born into cultures operating on background understandings that are embodied in inherited norms of action. Borrowing from Husserl and others, Habermas calls this stock of understandings the “lifeworld.”

The lifeworld is an important if somewhat slippery idea in Habermas’ work. One way to understand his particular interpretation of it is through the lens of his debate with Gadamer. Broadly speaking, Habermas agrees with the view of language held by Gadamer and hermeneutics generally: language is not simply a tool to convey information, its most basic form is dialogic use in context, and it has an inbuilt aim of understanding. On such a view, objectivity is not just correspondence to an independent world but instead something that is ascribed to mutual understandings (about the world, relations to others, and oneself) intersubjectively achieved in communication. Moreover, communication has an underlying structure that makes understandings possible in the first place. Meaning is therefore in some sense parasitic on this background structure.

On this much Gadamer and Habermas agree. But Gadamer takes all this to mean that explicit understanding and misunderstanding are only possible due to a taken-for-granted understanding of cultural belonging and socialization into a natural language. Habermas agrees that culture and socialization are important, but is worried that Gadamer’s take on the background structures that form the “conditions of possibility” for meaning yields a relativistic “absolutization of tradition.” On Habermas’ interpretation the lifeworld encompasses the sort of belonging and socialization referred to by Gadamer, but it works with and is underpinned by certain deep structures of communication itself. For Habermas, the complementarity between the lifeworld and a particular manifestation of these deep structures in discourse and “communicative action” (below) is what lets one interrogate and progressively revise parts of the background stock of inherited understandings and validity claims, thereby avoiding either relativism or the dogmatic veneration of tradition.

For Habermas the lifeworld is a reservoir of taken-for-granted practices, roles, social meanings, and norms that constitutes a shared horizon of understanding and possible interactions. The lifeworld is a largely implicit “know-how” that is holistically structured and unavailable (in its entirety) to conscious reflective control. We pick it up by being socialized into the shared meaning patterns and personality structures made available by the social institutions of our culture: kinship, education, religion, civil society, and so on. The lifeworld sets out norms that structure our daily interactions. We don’t usually talk about the norms we use to regulate our behavior. We simply assume they stand on good reasons and deploy them intuitively.

But what if someone willfully breaks or explicitly rejects a norm? This calls for discourse to explain and repair the breach or alter the norm. As a micro-level example: if someone breaks a promise then they will be asked to justify their behavior with good reasons or apologize. Such communication is also called for when norms suffer more serious breakdowns: one may question the reasons behind norms and whether they remain valid, or run into a new and complex situation where it is unclear which norms, how, to what extent, and if they apply. Regardless of how serious the norm breach or breakdown is, we need to engage in discourse to repair, refine, and replenish shared norms that let us avoid conflict, stabilize expectations, and harmonize interests. Discourse is the legitimate modern mechanism to repair the lifeworld; it embodies what Habermas calls “communicative action.”

Communicative action can be seen as a practical attitude or way of engaging others that is highly consensual and that fully embodies the inbuilt aim of speech: reaching a mutual understanding. In later writings Habermas distinguishes weak and strong communicative action. The weak form is an exchange of reasons aimed at mutual understanding. The strong form is a practical attitude of engagement seeking fairly robust cooperation based in consensus about the substantive content of a shared enterprise. This allows solidarity to flourish. In either form, communicative action is distinct from “strategic action,” wherein socially interacting people aim to realize their own individual goals by using others like tools or instruments (indeed, he calls this type of action “instrumental” when it is solitary or non-social). A key difference between strategic and communicative action is that strategic actors have a fixed, non-negotiable objective in mind when entering dialogue. The point of their engagement is to appeal, induce, cajole, or compel others into complying with what they think it takes to bring their objective about. In contrast, communicatively acting parties seek a mutual understanding that can serve as the basis for cooperation. In principle, this involves openness to an altered understanding of one’s interests and aims in the face of better reasons and arguments.

The contrast between communicative and strategic action is tightly linked to the distinction between communicative and purposive rationality. Purposive rationality is when an actor adopts an orientation to the world focused on cognitive knowledge about it, and uses that knowledge to realize goals in the world. As noted, it has social (strategic) and non-social (instrumental) variants. Communicative rationality is when actors also account for their relation to one another within the norm-guided social world they inhabit, and try to coordinate action in a conflict free manner. On this model of rationality, actors not only care about their own goals or following the relevant norms others do, but also challenging and revising them on the basis of new and better reasons.

Approaching rationality after action orientations is not merely stylistic. Habermas notes that while many theorists start with rationality and then analyze action, the view of action that such an order of analysis primes us to accept can tacitly smuggle in quasi-ontological connotations about the possible relations actors can have amongst themselves and to the world. Indeed, this mistake figures into Habermas’ critique of Weber’s account of the progressive social rationalization ushered in by modernity. Weber framed Western rationalism in terms of “mastery of the world” and then naturally assumed the rationalization of society simply meant increased purposive rationality. As is apparent from Habermas’ account of social learning, this is not the only way to understand the “evolution” of societies or the species as a whole throughout history. By expanding rationality beyond purposive rationality Habermas is able to resist the Weberian conclusion that had been attractive to Horkheimer and Adorno: that modernity’s increasing “rationalization” yielded a world devoid of meaning, people focused on control for their own individual ends, and that the spread of enlightenment rationality went conceptually hand-and-glove with domination. Habermas feels the notion of rationality in his Theory of Communicative Action resists such critiques.

The contrast between communicative and strategic action mainly concerns how an action is pursued. Indeed, while these action orientations are mutually exclusive when seen from an actor’s perspective, the same goal can often be approached in either communicative or strategic ways. For instance, in my rural town I may have a discussion with neighbors whereby we determine we share an interest in having snow cleared from our road, and that the best way to do this is by taking turns clearing it. This could count as an instance of communicative action. But, imagine a wealthy and powerful recluse who is indifferent to his neighbors. He could just pay a snowplow to clear the road up until his driveway. He could also use his power to manipulate or threaten others to clear the snow for him (for example, he could call the mayor and hint he may withhold a campaign donation if the snow is not cleared). Strategic action is about eliciting, inducing, or compelling behavior by others to realize one’s individual goals. This differs from communicative action, which is rooted in the give-and-take of reasons and the “unforced force” of the best argument justifying an action norm.

Strategic action and purposive rationality are not always undesirable. There are many social domains where they are useful and expected. Indeed, they are often needed because communicative action is very demanding and modern societies are so complex that meeting these demands all the time is impossible. Speakers engaged in communicative action must offer justifications to achieve a sincerely held agreement that their goals and the cooperation to achieve them are seen as good, right, and true (see section 4). But, in complex and pluralistic modern societies, such demands are often unrealistic. Modern social contexts often lack opportunities for highly consensual discussion. This is why Habermas thinks weak communicative action is likely sufficient for low stakes domains where not all three types of validity claims predominate, and why strategic interaction is well-suited for other domains. For Habermas, modern societies require systematically structured social domains that relax communicative demands yet still achieve a modicum of societal integration.

Habermas takes the institutional apparatus of the administrative state and the capitalist market to be paradigmatic examples of social integration via “systems” rather than through the lifeworld. For example, if a state bureaucracy administers a benefit or service it takes itself to be enacting prior decisions of the political realm. As such, open-ended dialogue with a claimant makes no sense: someone either does or does not qualify; a law either does or does not apply. Similarly, in a clearly defined and regulated market actors know where market boundaries lie and that everyone within the market is strategically engaged. Each market actor seeks individual benefit. It makes little sense to attempt an open-ended dialogue in a context where one supposes all others are acting strategically for profit. Both domains coordinate action, but not through robustly cooperative and consensual communication that yields solidarity. Certainly, not all large-scale and institutionalized interaction is strategic. Some social domains like scientific collaboration or democratic politics institutionalize reflexive processes of communicative action (see section 5 on democratic theory). In such fora cooperation may yield solidarity across the enterprise. Even so, the systems integration like that found in bureaucracies or markets sharply differs from integration through communicative action.

It should be stressed that these are simply paradigmatic examples, and that the same social domain can be institutionalized differently across societies. It is therefore more useful to look at the coordinative media that are typically used to interact with and steer any given institutionalized system rather than positing a fictive typology of clear social domains wherein it is assumed that either strategic or communicative action takes place. Habermas identifies three such media: speech, money, and power. Speech is the medium by which understanding is achieved in communicative action, while money and power are non-communicative media that coordinate action in realms like state bureaucracies or markets. A medium may largely be used in one social domain but that doesn’t mean it has no role in others. While speech is certainly the main medium of healthy democratic politics, this doesn’t mean money and power never play a role.

This all might seem to imply that there is no single correct way for system and lifeworld to jointly achieve social integration. Indeed, the complementarity between system and lifeworld laid out in Theory of Communicative action is broad enough to accommodate a wide range of institutional pluralism with respect to the structure of markets, bureaucracies, politics, scientific collaboration, and so on. But, the claim that there is no “one size fits all template” for social integration should not be taken as the claim that system and lifeworld have no proper relationship. Socialization into a lifeworld precedes social integration via systems. This is true historically and at the individual level.

Moreover, Habermas claims the lifeworld has conceptual priority with respect to systems integration. His thinking runs as follows: the lifeworld is the codified (yet revisable) stock of mutual normative understandings available to any person for consensually regulating social interaction; it is the reservoir of communicative action. Systems integration represents carefully circumscribed realms of instrumental and strategic action wherein we are released from the full demands of communicative action. Yet the very definition and limitation of these realms always depends on communicative action regarding, for example, the types of markets or state administration a community wants to have and why. Without being rooted in the mutual understandings of the lifeworld, we would get untrammeled systems of money and power disconnected from the intersubjectively vouchsafed practical reason that Habermas thinks underpins all meaning. The organizing principles of systems themselves would stop being coherent. For instance, market competition makes sense against a backdrop of normative principles like fairness, equal opportunity to compete, rules against capitalizing on secret information, and so on. But if markets were so “no-holds-barred” that these principles no longer applied, then engaging in market activity would cease to make sense. Similarly, if markets were so regulated that there was no genuine risk or opportunity they would also start to loose coherence as an enterprise. In both these skewed hypothetical scenarios the system is rigged and thus, if there are functional alternatives, it is not worth participating in. This is a variant of his early anti-technocracy argument. Positing “objective necessities” like economic growth, social stability, national security and then circumventing communicative action veils disagreement on what type of growth, stability, and security is important for a given community and why. As such, systems designed to achieve these ends are primed to loose coherence and legitimacy based in widely accepted structuring principles.

Habermas thinks the lifeworld self-replenishes through communicative action: if we come to reject inherited mutual understandings embedded in our normative practices, we can use communicative action to revise those norms or make new ones. Mechanisms of systems integration depend on this lifeworld backdrop for their coherence as enterprises achieving a modicum of social integration. The trouble is that systems have their own self-perpetuating logic that, if unchecked, will “colonize” and destroy the lifeworld. This is a main thesis in Theory of Communicative Action: strategic action embodied in domains of systems integration must be balanced by communicative action embodied in reflexive institutions of communicative action such as democratic politics. If a society fails to strike this balance, then systems integration will slowly encroach on the lifeworld, absorb its functions, and paint itself as necessary, immutable, and beyond human control. Current market and state structures will take on a veneer of being natural or inevitable, and those they govern will no longer have the shared normative resources with which they could arrive at mutual understandings about how they collectively want their institutions to look like. According to Habermas, this will lead to a variety of “social pathologies” at the micro level: anomie, alienation, lack of social bonds, an inability to take responsibility, and social instability.

In Theory of Communicative Action Habermas pins his hopes for resisting the colonization of the lifeworld on appeals to invigorate and support new social movements at the grassroots level, as they can directly draw upon the normative resources of lifeworld. This model of democratic politics essentially urges groups of engaged democratic citizens to shore up the boundaries of the public sphere and civil society against encroaching domains of systems integration such as the market and administrative state. This is why his early political theory is often called a “siege model” of democratic politics. As section 5 will show, this model was heavily revised in Between Facts and Norms. Before turning to that work, we must flesh out discourse ethics—an idea that figured into Theory and Communicative Action but which was only fully developed later.

4. Discourse Ethics

Habermas’s moral theory is called discourse ethics. It is designed for contemporary societies where moral agents encounter pluralistic notions of the good and try to act on the basis of publically justifiable principles. This theory first received explicit and independent articulation in Moral Consciousness and Communicative Action (German 1983, English 1990a) and Justification and Application (German 1991a, English 1993), but it was anticipated by and depends on ideas in Theory of Communicative Action. The overview that follows draws upon these works. Much like the prior section, it only traces the broad outline of discourse ethics.

Discourse ethics applies the framework of a pragmatic theory of meaning and communicative rationality to the moral realm in order to show how moral norms are justified in contemporary societies. It could be seen as a theory that uncovers what we pragmatically do when we make and defend the moral validity claims underlying and manifested in our norms. Yet, we need to be careful with this characterization. Because of its cognitive commitments to moral learning and knowledge discourse ethics cannot simply be a reconstructive description of how it is we practically avoid conflicts and stabilize expectations in post-conventional social contexts. It is also an attempt to provide a formal procedure for determining which norms are in fact morally right, wrong, and permissible. Discourse ethics is squarely situated in the tradition of Neo-Kantian deontology in that it takes the rightness and wrongness of obligations and actions to be universal and absolute. On such a view, the same moral norms apply to all agents equally. They strictly bind one to performing certain actions, prohibit others, and define the boundaries of permissibility. There is no “relative” validity of genuinely moral norms even though, as we shall see, they can be embedded in social contexts that have consequences for their application. As long as these caveats are kept in mind we can understand discourse ethics by analyzing the practice of making and defending validity claims and how there are certain conditions of possibility tacitly underpinning and enabling this practice.

What are the conditions that enable this practice? As touched on above, Habermas posits certain unavoidable pragmatic presuppositions of speech which, when realized in discourse, can approximate a counterfactual ideal speech situation to greater or lesser degrees (1971; MCCA, 86). Discourse participants need to presuppose these conditions in order for the practice of discursive justification to make sense and for arguments to be truly persuasive. Four of these presuppositions are identified as the most important: (i.) no one who could make a relevant contribution is excluded, (ii.) participants have equal chances to make a contribution, (iii.) participants sincerely mean what they say, and (iv.) assent or dissent is motivated by the strength of reasons and their ability to persuade through discursive argumentation rather than through coercion, inducement, and so on (BNR, 82; TIO, 44). The point is not that actual discourses ever realize these conditions—this is why the ideal speech situation is best understood as a counterfactual regulative ideal. Rather, the point is that the outcomes of any discourses are only reasonably taken to be “valid” (empirically true, morally right, and so forth) under the presumption that these conditions have been sufficiently met. As soon as a violation is discovered this casts doubt upon the validity of the discursive outcome.

In addition to these pragmatic presuppositions Habermas proposes his discourse principle (D). This principle is supposed to capture the type of impartial, discursive justification of practical norms required in post-conventional societies: “only those action norms are valid to which all possibly affected persons could agree as participants in rational discourse”. (BFN 107; TIO 41) While (D) was initially framed as a principle for moral discourses it was soon revised to the more general form above, as there are many practical norms concerning interpersonal interaction that are not directly moral even if they must be compatible with morality. Yet even in its broadened form it is crucial to note that (D) only applies to discourses concerning practical norms about interpersonal behavioral expectations, not all discourses about theoretical, aesthetic, or therapeutic concerns (which may or may not involve interpersonal social interaction). The guiding thought is that if discourses about an action norm are carried out in a sufficiently ideal manner and they yield consensus then this is a good indication the norm is valid. The principle does not hold that consensus reached through discourse constitutes validity, nor that whatever norm people coalesce around after discourse that looks sufficiently ideal is assured to be valid. Rather, (D) simply holds that consensus about a norm can be a good test of validity if it has been achieved in the right type of discursive way. It is important to note that, because of its very broad scope, (D) mainly functions by pointing out invalid norms. By itself the discourse principle cannot tell us which norms are valid. It can only help us identify norms that are good candidates for validity.

Moreover, before the validity of an action norm can be assessed, we need more details on the types of discourse and validity claims at issue (TIO 42). Within his project of discourse ethics Habermas identifies moral, ethical, and pragmatic discourses (JA 1-17; MCCA 98). Each type deploys practical reason differently, framing and analyzing questions under the rubrics of the purposive (practical), the good (ethical), or the just (moral). The language of differing discourse “types” should not be taken to mean that norms come prepackaged in distinct kinds. Instead, any norm can be discursively thematized in any of these ways and should not be arbitrarily limited to a given type. With that caution in mind, we can begin to understand discourse types and the norms they produce.

Ethical discourses are a good place to start. For, while they are constrained by the outcomes of moral discourses and therefore not foundational, our prior discussion of the lifeworld provides an apt segue. Ethical discourses are paradigmatically about clarifying, consciously appropriating, and realizing the identity, history, and self-understanding of a group or individual. They make validity claims to authenticity rather than truth or rightness. They also involve value judgments about a particular social form or practice concerning the good life in a community. This is one reason why the outcomes of ethical discourses will have relative validity: they are meant to redeem validity claims for actors in some community or another. Another reason is that values differ from the types of generalizable or universalizable interests embodied in moral norms. While moral norms are supposed to strictly oblige agents to either do or not do some action, values admit of degree. While moral norms express principles backed by reasons, values are affective components of meaning acquired in virtue of living in a given social context. They are connected to reasons but not reducible to them. Values can orient us to goals, aid motivation, and help successfully navigate the lifeworld but cannot ground moral obligations by themselves. Values attract or repel but do not persuade; they can provide motivation to “do the right thing”—to have the will to follow a moral insight—but they do not constitute or even always help us discern what “the right thing” is (BFN 255).

Ethical discourses are rooted in ethicality (Sittlichkeit), which is distinct from morality (Moralität). Like many philosophers, Habermas separates the realm of the right from the realm of the good. Following a loosely Hegelian terminology, he parses this as the difference between morality and ethicality. Ethicality is a way of life composed of both cognitive and affective elements as well as more structural elements that reproduce this way of life: laws, institutions, conventions, social roles, and so forth. It is particularistic in that it defines goals in terms of what is good for a group as a whole and its members. As Habermas believes in George Herbert Mead’s model of “individuation through socialization,” ethicality is deeply engrained and connected to the lifeworld. No one can simply drop their internalized ethical perspective just as no one can simply step out of the lifeworld they have inherited. Individuals are always in some sense bound up with the identity, practices, and values of their upbringing and traditions even if they come to largely reject them. But, as was clear from Habermas’ critique of Gadamer, ethical perspectives do not determine us. Ethical discourses explain how this is by mediating between inheritance and transcendence. While we inherit and internalize an ethical perspective as individuals, we can always question parts of it that we wish to challenge, refashion, or reject for lack of sufficient reasons underwriting certain norms.

This dialectic between the ethicality we internalize through socialization and the way in which we wish to consciously reappropriate and (dis)own portions of such ethicality helps to explain why, in contrast to other discourse types, Habermas pays a great deal of attention to ethical discourses at both the individual and group levels. Ethical discourses at the individual level are called ethical-existential while ethical discourses at the group level are referred to as ethical-political discourse. For example, an individual considering a certain profession would engage in an ethical-existential discourse (for example, is this profession right for me given my character and goals?), while a polity considering whether certain policies express their collective interest, identity, and values would engage in an ethical-political discourse (for example, does this policy align with the collective identity and commitments we have had and how we want to appropriate them moving forward?).

There are two key points about these levels. First, the outcomes of such discourses are constrained by morality irrespective of what would be authentic at individual or group levels: an individual cannot simply decide to become a serial killer just as a country cannot simply enact a policy that has patently immoral consequences (for example, for those outside it). While Habermas thinks it is important to account for the way in which morality is embedded in social contexts through ethical discourses, he is staunchly opposed to postmodern or communitarian takes on morality and justice. Second, there will often be a reflexive interplay between these two levels of ethical discourse. Discourses about what it means to genuinely inhabit a collective identity can impact the ordering and strength of the values held by individuals, and discourses about who one fundamentally is and wishes to be can, through resistance to dominant interpretations of traditions and highlighting unacknowledged injustices, impact how others in a collectivity appropriate their identity and normative practices moving forward. This interplay is bookended by broader moral discourses at both levels, thereby helping the outcomes of such discourses stay in the realm of permissibility.

Pragmatic discourses are similar to ethical discourses in that they start from the teleological perspective of an agent who already has a goal. But in contrast to the reflexive, clarifying, and potentially transformative self-realization and collective self-determination of ethical discourses, pragmatic discourses simply start with a goal of presumed value and set about realizing it. This goal may involve identity and values but it could also refer to more pedestrian concerns and interests. Because the goal is presumed to be worthwhile the values, interests, or goals at issue show up as relatively static. Pragmatic discourses simply focus on the most efficient way to realize or bring about a goal, and their claim to validity concerns whether or not certain strategies or interventions in the world are likely to produce a desired result. As Habermas puts it, pragmatic discourses correlate “causes to effects in accordance with value preferences and prior goal determinations” so as to generate a “relative ought” that expresses “what one “ought” or “must” do when faced with a particular problem if one wants to realize certain values or goals” (JA 3). The “ought” is relative because it is something akin to a rule of prudence that depends on whether an agent happens to have a certain interest or find a goal worth pursuing.

Finally, we turn to what might be seen as the most important type of discourse: moral discourses. Moral discourses are broader in scope and establish stronger validity claims than either ethical or pragmatic discourses. They seek to discern and justify norms that bind universally rather than simply in the confines of a specific community or because an agent happens to find a goal valuable. These norms have binarily coded, unconditional validity instead of the gradated, relative validity of the outcomes produced by pragmatic and ethical discourses.

In order to discursively discern this non-relative sense of moral validity Habermas proposes a separate principle, his principle of universalization (U), for discourses about moral norms: “A norm is valid when the foreseeable consequences and side effects of its general observance for the interests and value orientations of each individual could be jointly accepted by all concerned without coercion” (TIO 42). While (U) has gone through several different formulations, the basic idea is that for whatever valid moral norms there are, such norms can be accepted by all affected persons in a sufficiently ideal discourse wherein they assert their own interests and values. (U) checks if the norms we take to be moral actually are in virtue of whether or not they are universalizable. If they are not universalizable, they cannot be moral norms. Beyond this basic characterization there are some interpretive issues with (U). Three are worth brief focus: its apparent reference to consequences, where (U) comes from, and the role of interests.

First, in the version of (U) above, it is easy to mistake the “foreseeable consequences and side effects” clause with the addition of a mild consequentialist constraint. Given Habermas’ deontological commitments this would be odd. Instead, the clause builds in a “time and knowledge index” so that it does not make impossible demands on moral agents. Fully satisfying (U) would require discourse participants who had unlimited time, complete knowledge, and no illusions about their own interests and values; it would require participants who transcended their human condition. As (U) must be usable in the real world it can only ask that moral discourse participants attempt to account for the “anticipated typical situations” to which a norm would apply when they attempt to justify any moral norm (JA 37). The circumscribed task of (U) is key: it is only supposed to justify moral norms in the abstract. While this justification may point towards “typical” cases of application, it does not predetermine all applications. What about novel, atypical, or completely unforeseen situations to which the norm might unexpectedly apply?

Following Klaus Günther, Habermas claims that moral (and legal) decisions in specific cases require a logic of appropriateness found in discourses of application (Günther 1993; JA 35-37). Discourses of application look at a concrete case and survey all potentially applicable norms, relevant facts, and circumstances. They try to offer exhaustive or “complete” descriptions of a situation so as to decide among multiple, sometimes competing or only partly applicable norms that might regulate a situation. There is a division of labor between the two types of recursively related discourse: whereas discourses of justification lay out the reasons why we should endorse a norm as a general rule with reference to typical situations, discourses of application seek to apply norms to concrete cases which may be wholly new or defy expectations. As fallible agents we can make a variety of different errors in our discursive justification of a norm or fail to anticipate new situations or altered understandings of facts, values, and interests—a failure that would be revealed in application. Habermas calls this the “dual falliblist proviso,” and it instills an awareness that moral justification is an ongoing project (TJ 259). The recursive interplay of justification and application is supposed to progressively address prior errors and oversights. New insights gleaned from application discourses or novel situations can lead us to revisit norms whose justification was taken for granted, and this refinement of our understanding regarding how and why norms are justified will help us apply them better. If we had providential foreknowledge we would not need application discourses. But since we are fallible the “foreseeable consequences and side effects” should be seen as referring to an in-built “time and knowledge” index for the outcomes of justificatory discourses, which are then supplemented by application discourses that may impact the formulation of the initial norm.

The second interpretive issue is where (U) comes from. Habermas initially claimed that (U) could be formally deduced from a combination of the pragmatic presuppositions of discourse and (D), but weakened this claim shortly thereafter (JA 32 n17). Instead of deriving (U) from a formal deduction or informal inferences he now claims—using a term coined by Peirce—we arrive at (U) “abductively” (TIO 42). To arrive at something abductively is to suggest that we first observe a phenomenon (moral norms) and adopt a “best guess” hypothesis to explain it (the moral principle), which can then be subjected to further inductive testing (Ingram 2010, 47; Finlayson 2000a, 19). In short, (U) is now proposed as the best candidate principle for helping to explain moral normativity. To buttress the plausibility of this claim Habermas has also fallen back on his theory of social evolution and the “weak…notion of normative justification” in post-conventional contexts (TIO 45). Indeed, he now often speaks about (U) as following from the type of impartial justificatory procedure appropriate to a post-conventional condition that seeks to discern norms that are “equally in everyone’s interest,” “generalizable,” or “universalizable” (RPT 367; BFN 108, 460; TJ 265). The reference to interests leads us to the third interpretive issue with (U).

Early formulations of (U) only refer to interests (MCCA 65, 120). The inclusion of value orientations is potentially confusing. As noted above values are not necessarily cognitively grounded. As Habermas has always presented his moral theory as cognitivist it would be odd to give values such a central role. It seemed to make sense that initial formulations of (U) only included interests, as Habermas has defined interests in a cognitive fashion (on interests as “reasons to want” see Finlayson, 2000b). Bolstering an interpretation of (U) that puts priority on (cognitive) interests he has stated that “(U) works like a rule that eliminates as non-generalizable content all those concrete value orientations with which particular biographies or forms of life are permeated” (MCCA 121), and that the specific part of (U) referring to “uncoerced joint acceptance” means that any reasons put forth in moral discourse must “cast off their agent-relative meaning and take on an epistemic meaning from the standpoint of symmetrical considerations” (TIO 43). Moreover, the interpretive secondary literature has often emphasized the centrality of interests over values and focused on how Habermas often talks about “generalizable” or “universalizable” interests as the distinctive feature that moral norms secure (Heath 2003; Finlayson 2000b; Lafont 1999). How then should the inclusion of value orientations be understood?

Habermas has said he included value orientations in (U) so as to “prevent the marginalization of the self-understanding and worldviews of particular individuals and groups” (TIO 42). This does not mean that values are on a par with interests. Instead, his point is that interests and values are always bound together. Value orientations exert at least some indirect influence on moral discourses insofar as they subtly influence the very interpretation of our own interests (JA 90). Proceeding as if value orientations can be expunged from moral discourses may in fact introduce discursive blind spots. Indeed, candor about one’s own value-orientations may be crucial since the impartiality of (U) involves “generalized reciprocal perspective-taking” that cuts both ways: it orients participants towards “empathy for the self-understandings” of others as well as towards “interpretive interventions into the self-understanding of participants who must be willing to revise their descriptions of themselves and others” (TIO 43). The essential point is that even though “some of our needs are deeply rooted in our anthropology” and can be seen as basic generalizable interests shared by all, we must nevertheless avoid “ontologizing generalizable interests” into “some kind of given” because even “the interpretation of needs and wants must take place in terms of a public language” wherein our own self-understandings are open to revision (TJ 268; JA 90).

A final interpretive issue that merits attention is the precise status of moral rightness. Habermas has always held that morality and truth are analogous in that both are cognitive, binarily coded, and subject to learning processes. Moreover, he has always been sharply critical of approaches that would reduce morality to a purely subjective or relativized affair. Yet, given that rightness is not reducible to truth and that Habermas has repeatedly disclaimed a moral realist reading of his theory, it is unclear precisely how far this analogy is supposed to extend. This is not only because there are a variety of differences between empirical and moral knowledge but also because Habermas has changed his theory of truth over the years—moving from a consensus theory that identified truth with ideal warranted assertability to a “pragmatic epistemological realism that follows in the path of linguistic Kantianism” (TJ 7). Early articulations of discourse ethics seemed to admit of interpretations wherein rightness was a justification-transcendent concept that couldn’t be captured by ideal warranted assertability. This led some interpreters to interpret Habermas’ moral theory as at least tacitly committed to some variant of internal moral realism (Davis 1994, Kitchen 1997, Lafont 1999 and 2012, Smith 2006, Peterson 2010 ms.). But, in the course of resisting this reading, Habermas has explicitly claimed that, “ideally warranted assertability is what we mean by moral validity” (TJ 258, 248). He now wishes to articulate a notion of moral rightness that can be cashed out in terms of a pragmatist constructivism that also avoids the perils of relativism and skepticism—that is, which maintains an anti-realist account of moral rightness that still resists collapsing into a form of moral consensus theory. Whether he succeeds in this endeavor is a hotly debated topic.

5. Political and Legal Theory

In post-conventional, pluralistic societies ever fewer norms can be underwritten by a shared ethos embodied in a community’s ethicality or collective identity. Moral norms cannot pick up the slack to achieve social integration and cohesion by themselves. Because moral discourse is demanding and aims at what is equally in everyone’s interest, few moral norms will be seen as justified across the world or even in a given society (JA 91, TJ 265). And, as Habermas noted in Theory of Communicative Action, while systems like the bureaucratic state and economy can achieve stability and coordinate expectations through money and power, this can erode mutual understandings and social solidarity; markets and bureaucracies tend to displace and colonize the lifeworld. Indeed, his political essays from this period cast democratically created law as holding the line against system encroachments in a siege mentality (BFN 486-89, Habermas 1992b 444). This may leave us asking: What other resources exist for legitimate social integration?

In Habermas’ clearest statement of political theory, Between Facts and Norms, modern law shows up as precisely the resource we are looking for. If law is linked to democratic political structures in the right way it confers legitimacy on legal norms, thereby fostering social integration and stability. Broadly speaking, the relation between legal legitimacy, procedural-democratic popular sovereignty, and public discourse is nested and reflexive: legitimate law must be rooted in democracy, which itself depends upon a robust public sphere. A vibrant democratic public sphere is what allows for the revision and questioning of prior law. Conceived of in this way modern law is a “transformer” that preserves the normative achievements and mutual understandings that issue from the collective self-determination of the public sphere by translating them into legitimate, binding decisions that can “counter-steer” against the logics of the state and market. As long as legal decisions are arrived at in the right type of procedural, discursive fashion there is a presumption in favor of their rationality and legitimacy. And, as long as the public sphere continues to be a robust and open forum of contestation, any prior decisions are revisable such that there is a circulation between the informal public sphere and more formal institutions of the state. This focus on the transformative, mediating nature of law revises the prior “siege” model of democratic law into a procedural “sluice” model (Habermas 2002, 243). While the prior model saw democratically generated law as a defensive dam or shield against the demands of systems, the new model sees a certain type of lawmaking as mediating the circulation between lifeworld and system in a way that produces legitimate and binding legal norms. Modern law works with systems and alongside post-conventional morality to stabilize social expectations and resolve conflicts.

We can start to understand the relation between law, democracy, and the public sphere by focusing on legal legitimacy and democracy. Between Facts and Norms posits a tension within law itself, as well as an internal relation between modern law and democracy. To function, all law must demand compliance, threaten coercion, and (however tacitly) appeal to an underlying normative justification. Law is therefore characterized by a tension between “facticity” and “validity” insofar as it must be recognized as factually efficacious and normatively justified. This tension helps explain the relation between law and democracy in contemporary contexts. Pre-modern law appealed to God, nature, human reason, or shared culture for its justificatory backing. In post-conventional societies the fact that law is coercible and changeable yet merely rooted in fallible humans is laid bare. For Habermas, the underlying normative justification can now only be understood as “a mode of lawmaking that engenders legitimacy” (IO 254). The thought is that democracy is the only mode of lawmaking that is up to this legitimacy-engendering task. In light of these connections it is fruitful for present purposes to focus on “deliberations that end in legislative decision making” rather than treating political and legal legitimacy separately (BFN 171; Bohman and Rehg 1999, 36).

The democracy Habermas has in mind differs from overly populist varieties. He is clear that the legitimacy underwriting lawmaking must be twofold: law must not only express the democratic will of the community but must also be non-subordinately “harmonized” with morality (BFN 99, 106). This non-subordinate concordance of legality and discourse theoretic morality is the hardest sense of legitimacy to explain and the easiest to overlook, so it is fruitful to start there. For Habermas, “legal and moral rules…appear side by side as two different but mutually complementary kinds of action norms” in post-conventional societies. In order to also account for “the idea of self-legislation by citizens” we must avoid a “subordination of law to morality” along the lines of classical natural law theory (BFN 105-6, 120; IO 257). Yet it seems puzzling to hold that democratically determined law should be compatible with but not subordinate to discourse-theoretic morality. What about cases where law and morality seem to conflict? There are a few answers that highlight unique features in Habermas’ theory. At a general level these answers take the same shape: while there are many ways that legal systems can square with moral permissibility, there are nevertheless structural and conceptual features endogenous to processes of modern procedural-democratic popular sovereignty that, at least at an abstract level, tend to harmonize legal norms with moral permissibility. This avoids concerns with morality trumping legality in an exogenous manner.

One reason to expect that democratically legitimate law and moral permissibility will be at least in principle commensurable is that they are both rooted in (D). We saw above how the moral principle (U) expresses the way (D) is specified for moral discourses. Habermas also proposes a principle of democratic legitimacy (L) that expresses the way (D) is specified for political discourses producing law. This principle is rooted in (D) in virtue of what Habermas calls the “legal form.” When (D) is deployed in discourses aimed at producing legal norms for regulating common life together it is understood these norms will be cloaked in the legal form: the set of formal and functional features characterizing modern positive law. Modern positive law is enacted and conventional, enforceable and coercive, rooted in institutions with some reflexivity, tailored to protect individuals through rights, and limited in scope (BFN 111-118, IO 256). If law is to function as a tool for the consensual regulation of social conflicts and the integration of society, then it needs to take on this form.

The principle of democratic legitimacy (L) is part of the normative backing that is supposed to emerge, albeit in nuce and very abstractly, from the historical interpenetration of (D) and the legal form that has culminated in the structures of modern democratic state. It claims, “only those statutes may claim legitimacy that can meet with the assent of all citizens in a discursive process of legislation that in turn has been legally constituted” (BFN 110; constituted is sometimes translated as organized). This principle captures how (D) is specified for political discourses so that democratic procedures underwrite the legitimacy of legal norms. Legitimacy does not arise out of formal legality alone; it needs the added normative backing of democracy. The idea of (L) is that compliance with the law must be rational and rooted in the law’s perceived legitimacy. To achieve this, political discourses must be structured in a way where formal legislative institutions accurately represent and address deliberations going on in the informal public sphere, and where there are institutionalized procedural mechanisms organized in a way to help screen out weak arguments (BFN 340). The details of this structuring will be clarified below, particularly in relation to the process model and the relationship between democracy and the public sphere.

However, the mere fact that (U) and (L) are rooted in (D) does little to ensure the commensurability of law and discourse-theoretic morality. Fortunately, there are additional reasons why we might expect such a harmonization. Habermas thinks the combination of (D) and the legal form in (L) also supplies us with the resources to discern the conceptual kernels of an abstract “system of rights” that will be inscribed in the core structures of any legitimate self-determining political community. The basic argument is that in order for (L) to be realized it must make reference to a concrete community engaged in self-determination through modern law. In such communities equal legal personhood takes on the role of a “protective mask,” a formal identity mainly defined by rights instead of duties, that crystalizes around individual moral persons (BFN 531, 112). This legal identity is constituted by a core of rights that secure the status and private autonomy of individuals such that they can not only live their individual lives but also genuinely deliberate (on equal footing, free from coercion, and so forth) about the terms of shared life together. Yet, these individual rights cannot be effective unless they presuppose other rights to participation and basic material provision—rights that secure public autonomy. The claim is that the legal manifestations of private and public autonomy, often expressed in the idioms of human rights and popular sovereignty, mutually presuppose one another. What results is an abstract system of rights made up of five core types. What are these right types?

First, in order to discursively engage one another people need to be reasonably secure. Therefore, rights that guarantee the status of individual persons are required. Three types of rights jointly achieve such protection: (i.) the right to equal liberties compatible with those of others, (ii.) rights of membership that determine the extent of the community, and (iii.) rights of due process that assure each person is treated the same and equally protected under the law (BFN, 133-134). These rights secure the individual private autonomy prioritized by classical liberalism. But any community engaged in specifically democratic self-determination must also safeguard the ability to actively use the freedom afforded by this secure status to deliberate, disagree, and come to mutual understandings in concert with others. If individual rights are to be effectively used (iv.) rights of communication and political participation that formally secure equal opportunity and access to the political process are required. These rights secure the collective public autonomy prioritized by classical republicanism. They enable discourses in the public sphere as well as equal access to channels of political say and influence; they enable democratic popular sovereignty by making sure everyone can participate on fair and equal terms, and that information, innovative ideas and arguments about how to structure common life are kept freely circulating and scrutinized. Lastly, these four right types are insufficient if basic needs are threatened or go unmet. Formal guarantees of freedom and participation mean little if they amount to the freedom to starve. So, as a final step, Habermas proposes some measure of (v.) social, technological, and ecological rights securing the basic conditions of a minimally decent life. Democratic states have often done a poor job fully realizing these rights, but the claim is simply that these general right types are conceptually required if self-determination through law is to achieve the dual sense of legitimacy noted above. In this same spirit of clarification, it is also important to note that the abstract system only identifies certain right types, not some list of concrete rights. Communities have incredibly wide interpretive latitude when it comes to how these rights show up. Habermas often refers to rights as “unsaturated placeholders”; it is largely up to communities to “fill in” their content.

The expectation of a non-hierarchal harmonization of morality and legality may now seem less puzzling. Ideally, lawmaking discourses approximate (L) against the backdrop of an abstract system of rights inscribed in the political structures of a democratic community. This places some broad constraints on how deliberations unfold and the type of norms they can produce. Moreover, apart from these structural background constraints political discourses are also themselves unique. In contrast to moral discourses focused on “the interest of all” or ethical discourses focused on authentic self-realization, political discourses aimed at self-determination through law reference a plethora of different concerns, and do so in an internally-structured way aimed at carving out a space (defined by rights) where moral personhood and ethical authenticity can flourish (BFN 531).

While deliberations about “political questions are normally so complex that they require the simultaneous treatment of pragmatic, ethical, and moral aspects” of issues, they ideally unfold along a ‘process model’ where there is a structured interplay between pragmatic, ethical, and moral concerns as well as procedurally regulated bargaining (BFN 565, 168). The basic idea is that for any provisional policy conclusion there is an obligation to respond to objections stemming from more abstract aspects of an issue or levels of discourse; discursive processes cannot be arbitrarily limited. For instance, participants in a discourse on immigration policy cannot simply consult ethical concerns regarding their community’s authentic identity but yet refuse to listen to moral discourses that bear on such policies. Any moral aspects need to be explicitly discussed, and they filter or check more particularistic issue-aspects and discourses (Cf. BFN 169 and the emendation at 565 on whether to refer to the structured interplay as between discourses or aspects of a case). The abstract system of rights and the process model mean that, within political deliberations about how to structure common life together, it will in principle always be possible for more abstract moral discourses to weakly check pragmatic and ethical-political discourses. And, this checking will be endogenous to structures of democratic self-determination.

So far the focus has been on the relation between law and democracy without much reference to the public sphere. However, it is hard to overstate the importance Habermas places on democratic deliberation rooted in the public sphere. None of the formal or structural mechanisms mentioned so far guarantee that public political discourses or laws will be specified in a given way. There is assurance neither that the abstract system of rights or (L) will be meaningfully realized, nor that the interplay of various types of concerns in political discourses will unfold along the process model. Everything hangs on the quality and institutional structuring of deliberation in the public sphere. Indeed, the primary reason why democracy confers legitimacy upon legislative outcomes is that it is rooted in a model of distinctly procedural popular sovereignty that simultaneously expresses the will of the community and that leads to more rational outcomes. An analysis of the specific way in which democracy and the public sphere are related on Habermas’ model is the best way to understand how the democratic mode of lawmaking underwrites the legitimacy of legal norms.

In Between Facts and Norms Habermas proposes a “two-track” model of democratic politics outlining a circulation of political power engendering legitimacy. He divides the political public sphere into informal and formal parts. The informal public sphere includes all the various voluntary associations of civil society: religious and charitable organizations, political associations, the media, and public interest advocacy groups of all varieties (BFN 355). In this sphere public political deliberation is free and unorganized. Through this open clash of views and arguments individuals and collectivities can both persuade and be persuaded, thereby contributing to the emergence of considered public opinions. In contrast, the formal public sphere includes institutionalized forums of discourse and deliberation like congress, parliament, and the judiciary as well as more peripheral administrative and bureaucratic agencies associated with state structures. This sphere is supposed to be organized in such a way that it renders decisions reflecting the considered public opinions of the informal public sphere. Formal institutionalized decision making bodies must be porous to results of the informal public sphere.

The informal public sphere is the key forum for generating a type of normative power that can integrate society through mutual understandings and solidarity rather than through money or administrative-bureaucratic power. When discourse participants in the informal public sphere freely reach mutual understandings about how to regulate the terms of shared life together “communicative power” emerges (Flynn 2004 discusses communicative power’s precise locus). Communicative power arises from jointly authored norm expectations that are cognitively grounded in the force of better reasons and motivationally grounded (albeit weakly) in mutual recognition and collective ethical discourses. Cognitively speaking, free communication in the public sphere can foster “rational opinion and will-formation” because “the free processing of information and reasons, of relevant topics and contributions is meant to ground the presumption that results reached in accordance with correct [discursive] procedure are rational” (BFN 147). This acceptance also provides weak motivation: in accepting a norm’s validity claim one accepts the background understandings and reasonins underlying it which can motivate relevant circumstances. Moreover, because this mutual understanding was presumably reached through persuasive discourse where reasoned dissent was (and remains) a real possibility, norm acceptance can also motivate in a spirit of anti-paternalistic empowerment: parties recognize each other as accountable and responsible for their actions in accord with a norm until new counter-reasons are discovered. While they may be aware of counter-inclinations and motives that are not backed by good reasons, they take one another to be competent, responsible agents who can choose to act on rationally backed norms (Günther 1998). Yet, because the motivation accompanying cognitive insight is fragile and weak, communicative power must also be rooted in a community with a shared ethical-political identity and legitimate law so that motivational deficits can be met with supplemental resources of a shared life and law.

Communicative power can only arise if the informal public sphere has certain characteristics. First and foremost, it must be relatively free of distortions, coercion, and silencing social pressures so that communication can work as a filter for fostering more rational individual and collective will formation (BFN 360). The public sphere also needs to accurately function as a “context of discovery” wherein problems that affect large segments of the public are identified and taken up for discussion and resolution in discourse. Moreover, civil society must be animated by a political culture so that members actively participate in voluntary associations and public discourse about the terms of common life together (BFN 371). Normative power potentials cannot be generated if members largely retreat into private concerns or a society is internally segmented and riven with special interests (Flynn (2004) 439-444; Bohman and Rehg (1999) 41-42). Clearly, if the public sphere is to remain healthy then the media’s role in fostering accurate information and timely mass communication will also be crucial (EFP, 138-183).

The political institutions of the formal public sphere are arranged so as to be porous to the inputs of the informal public sphere, to further refine and focus public opinion, and to make decisions. Building on the work of Bernhard Peters, Habermas maintains that modern constitutional democracies are set up so communication and decision-making flow from the “periphery” of the informal public sphere into the “center” constituted by those formal political institutions that create, enforce, clarify, or implement the law (BFN 354). In a well-functioning democratic regime there will be structural “sluices” or “floodgates” embedded in the institutions of the administrative state (legislature, judiciary, and so forth) so that the circulatory flow of power proceeds in the right direction, from the periphery to the center.

The thought is that the political community should “program” and direct the institutions of the administrative complex, not the other way around (BFN 356). If the state or other powerful actors reverse this flow by simply positing new laws or rules and either demanding compliance or inducing it in some other way, then this exercise of non-communicative administrative-bureaucratic power would be neither legitimate nor stable. Habermas claims the “integrative capacity of democratic citizenship” erodes to the extent that the circulation of political power is interrupted or reversed. Only communicative power has the legitimating force needed so that a community can both author and rationally abide by the law. Democratic lawmaking is the key institution that “represents…the medium for transforming communicative power into administrative power” while preserving its normative potential (BFN 169, 81, 299). Democratically generated law ensures normative power potentials flow in the right direction and that they are maintained when implemented by institutions of the administrative state.

This account of procedural-democratic collective self-determination should not be confused with traditional national self-determination. Habermas rejects models of sovereign collective self-determination that presuppose a nation or people with a homogeneous identity and interests, as well as models where “a network of associations” stands-in for this (imaginary) collective-self (BFN 185, 486). Instead, in modern constitutional democracies the “idea of popular sovereignty is… desubstantialized [and]…not even embodied in the heads of the associated members.” Popular sovereignty “is found in those subjectless forms of communication that regulate the flow of discursive opinion- and will- formation in such a way that their fallible outcomes have the presumption of practical reason on their side” (BFN 486). Insofar as we can speak about the will of a community it is an anonymous and subjectless public opinion emerging out of the discursive structures of communication themselves (BFN 136, 171, 184-186, 299, 301). This unique interpretation of popular sovereignty helps explain some final aspects of Habermas’ political theory: his views on religion and the public sphere, his constitutional patriotism, and his vision of politics beyond the nation-state.

In early writing Habermas claimed that as the rationality and pluralism of enlightenment ideals slowly took hold in modern societies the mythic explanations of religion would be less important. But, he slowly came to revise his view on religion in modern societies. At present, the way he sees religion fitting into the public sphere of a liberal democracy is what is important. In liberal democracies, untrammeled populism is held in check by not only individual rights but also the very nature of public debate: citizens collectively self-determine through persuasion and rational argumentation. To do this amidst the pluralism of modernity, the laws they make must be grounded in public reasons accessible to all. The question is what this means for religious citizens.

There have been a variety of answers. For instance, in Political Liberalism John Rawls held that liberal democratic citizens should ultimately only endorse policies that they can support on the basis of secular reasons. While these citizens may have religious reasons that favor a law or policy, when engaged in political debate they must eventually “translate” these reasons into terms that non-believers could accept. Habermas is sympathetic to the vision of liberal democracy animating this view of how religious citizens should act. Indeed, he criticizes thinkers like Wolterstorff who insist that religious citizens ought to be allowed to try to base coercive law on their own particularistic values and conception of the good. Nevertheless, he feels that placing the burden of “translation” onto religious citizens alone is somewhat misguided. Such an approach underestimates the ethical-existential importance of religion in some people’s lives—especially if it is bound up with the structure of their lifeworld and identity. As an alternative, Habermas proposes both religious and non-religious citizens be allowed to invoke any reasons for or against policies at the level of the informal public sphere, provided they take one another’s claims seriously and do not dismiss them from the outset. But when it comes to the institutions of the formal public sphere concerning coercive lawmaking, justifications should only be based in reasons that all can accept.

This view is somewhat unsatisfying for several reasons: it simply moves the asymmetrical burden of translation “up a level,” it may run into concerns of a metaphorical split in identity, and it could even saddle non-religious citizens with undue burdens (Yates 2007, Lafont 2009). For present purposes, the most charitable reading is that Habermas assumes all democratic citizens have an obligation to adopt a thoroughly self-reflective attitude. Religious citizens must “self-modernize” insofar as they are expected to be open to things like the authority of science, the need for non-religious reasons backing coercive law, and the possible validity of claims made by other religions. But, this also means non-religious citizens must move beyond a dogmatic secularist understanding wherein it is impossible for religious claims to have any cognitive value whatsoever. Indeed, given that some fundamental moral notions—such as equal human dignity—have been inextricably tied to the history of world religions, he claims it is not always clear where the boundaries of the religious and secular are. Determining these boundaries (and what can count as publicly acceptable) may at times be a cooperative task wherein each side takes the claims of the other with some degree of seriousness (2006b, 45 and 2003b, 109).

Habermas’ reinterpretation of popular sovereignty also explains why he has adopted the theory of constitutional patriotism pioneered by Dolf Sternberger. Constitutional patriotism maintains that, in contrast to national identities of the past, modern political communities can base their collective identities around the unique ways they appropriate and embed the abstract, universalistic principles of democratic self-determination within their unique histories and traditions. On such a model, political allegiance can coalesce around “a particularist anchoring of…the universalist meaning of [principles such as] popular sovereignty and human rights” (BFN 500; L’i 308; BNR 106). This particularist anchoring would presumably include the way in which a community takes up the abstract system of rights, the process model, and (L). The claim is that the specific way a political community instantiates the “abstract procedures and principles” of the modern democratic state fosters the development of a “liberal political culture” that “crystalizes” around that country’s constitutional traditions, structures, and discursive fora (IO 118; DW 78). The integrative force that emerges against this backdrop is called civic solidarity, which Habermas characterizes as “an abstract, legally mediated solidarity among citizens… a political form of solidarity among strangers” (DW 79; BNR 22). This is essentially the integrative potential of democratic citizenship when it is actively used.

One assumption here is that “culture and national politics have become…differentiated” from one another; citizens can see themselves as part of a shared political culture precisely because they no longer see the state as a vehicle for realizing a homogenous, pre-political nation. While this is a far cry from empirical realities in many parts of the world, Habermas sees the European Union as illustrative in this regard. Even in a context that was once characterized by strong national identities (where the chances for such an identity might seem slimmer than in more multicultural contexts) we can start to see how “a common political culture could differentiate itself off from the various national cultures” and how “identifications with one’s own forms of life and traditions [could be] overlaid with a patriotism that has become more abstract, that now relates… to abstract procedures and principles” (NC 261; BFN 507, 465; IO 118; BNR 327; DW 78).

Finally, Habermas sees constitutional patriotism as a normative resource that could help to expand civic solidarity across political borders and uncouple legal structures from the nation-state so they could be scaled-up into new institutions of international law. Such developments would allow new forms of democratic self-governance above the nation-state at regional and global levels (DW 79). These post-national implications are naturally produced by Habermas’ core theoretical commitments. Deliberative democracy is committed to institutionalized discourse that in some way makes it possible for law to be justified to the persons who are affected by or subjected to it. Given increasing global interdependence this obviously pushes in cosmopolitan directions. However, at the same time, it is important to remember that communicative power must be rooted in a community with a shared ethical-political identity, and that constitutional patriotism is parasitic upon a particular political culture. This rootedness means that civic solidarity and new forms of self-governance can stretch, but only so far.

This anchored cosmopolitanism yields a multi-level constitutionalization of international law that aims at some measure of global governance without government. While Habermas’ account of such a multi-level system is only a sketch and many details need filling-in, the broad outline is clear. He proposes a system comprised of the “supranational” (global), “transnational” (regional), and national level political institutions with different roles. A supranational organization akin to a reformed United Nations is envisioned as securing international peace, security, and core human rights. At the mid-level, transnational authorities like the EU would tackle technical issues through coordinative efforts and political issues through negotiated bargaining among sufficiently representative regional regimes of commensurate stature. Finally, nation-states would retain their status as the locus of democratic legitimation. This would require the spread of democratic structures to each nation-state so that laws can reflect the will of the community and so that they could be reliably in line with the basic human rights secured by a supranational organization.

This vision of a multi-level political system for the constitutionalization of international law can be criticized as demanding both too much and too little. Habermas’ version of cosmopolitan deliberative democracy locates the touchstone of legitimacy in the fact that “citizens are subject only to those laws which they have given themselves in accordance with democratic procedure” (CEU 14). From this perspective of democratically legitimate law, the proposed system may demand too little. Despite Habermas’ insistence that negotiation between regional regimes could take place in a way that would not “impair deliberation and inclusion,” it is hard to see how such bargaining could really constitute a process where citizens give themselves the law through democratic procedures (CEU 19). From the perspective of rootedness in political culture, the multi-level system may also demand too much with the extension of civic solidarity to transnational regimes. Habermas clearly thinks there are limits to such an extension, as “the transnational extension of civic solidarity…comes to nothing…when it is supposed to assume a global format.” However, apart from the fact that neighboring countries might be supposed to have some minimal level of shared history and culture born out of territorial proximity and an interdependency of interests, it is unclear why this extension of solidarity would reach the levels needed to underwrite the democratic legitimacy of laws within transnational units of regional governance (CEU 62).

While Habermas is certainly aware of these criticisms, he is largely focused on defending his political theory in broad, systematic terms. If the broad normative outlines are correct then the overall theory will stand regardless of how the empirical details are filled in. Indeed, Habermas is rather unique among contemporary philosophers both in his systematic approach to large areas of theory and in his willingness to allow others to fill in the details of how particular claims might work. He has always insisted that philosophers do not speak from a privileged place of knowledge. The best that they can hope for is to articulate a theory that can be convincingly and rigorously tested and debated in the public sphere. We can perhaps understand not only his political theory, but several other theoretical projects in this spirit of a public intellectual putting forth a theory for testing and debate that requires further articulation by those who come after.

6. References and Further Reading

a. General Introductions to Habermas

The article presented a general and reasonably complete introduction to Habermas. However, given the breadth of his work and space constraints, the following should also be consulted:

• 1978. McCarthy, Thomas. The Critical Theory of Jürgen Habermas.  The MIT Press.
• 1988. White, Stephen K. The Recent Work of Jürgen Habermas. Cambridge University Press.
• 2005. Finlayson, James Gordon. Habermas: A Very Short Introduction. Oxford University Press.
• 2011. Fultner, Barbara (ed.) Jürgen Habermas: Key Concepts. Acumen Press.
• 2014. Bohman, James and Rehg, William. Jürgen Habermas. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Thomas Gregersen maintains an online bibliography at the Habermas Forum.

The following printed bibliographies are also useful:

• 2013. Corchia, Luca. Jürgen Habermas. A Bibliography: Works and Studies (1952-2013). Pisa (IT): Arnus University Books.
• 2014. Müller-Doohm, Stephan. Jürgen Habermas – Eine Biographie. Berlin: Suhrkamp.

b. Introductory Books and Articles on Specific Themes

i. Biography

• 2001. Matustik, Martin Beck. Jürgen Habermas: A Philosophical-Political Profile. Rowman and Littlefield.
• 2010. Specter, Matthew G. Habermas: An Intellectual Biography. Cambridge University Press.
• 2004. Wiggershaus, Rolf. Jürgen Habermas. Reinbek Bei Hamburg: Rowohlt.

ii. Linguistic Turn

• 1994. Cooke, Maeve. Language and Reason. The MIT Press.
• 1999. Lafont, Cristina. The Linguistic Turn in Hermeneutic Philosophy. Jose Medina (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
• 2016. Lafont, Cristina. Jürgen Habermas in The Blackwell Companion to Hermeneutics, 440-445.

iii. Discourse Ethics

• 1994. Davis, Felmon John. Discourse Ethics and Ethical Realism: A Realist Realignment of Discourse Ethics. European Journal of Philosophy, 125-142.
• 1997. Rehg, William. Insight and Solidarity: The Discourse Ethics of Jürgen Habermas. University of California Press.
• 2000a. Finlayson, James Gordon. Modernity and Morality in Habermas’s Discourse Ethics. Inquiry. 43, 319-40.

iv. Political Theory

• 1994. Bohman, James. Review: Complexity, Pluralism, and the Constitutional State: On Habermas’s Faktizitat und Geltung. Law and Society Review, 897-930.
• 2002. Discourse and Democracy: Essays on Habermas’s Between Facts and Norms, ed. Rene von Schomberg and Kenneth Baynes. SUNY Press.
• 2010. Hedrick, Todd. Rawls and Habermas: Reason, Pluralism, and the Claims of Political Philosophy. Stanford University Press

c. Works Cited

Most of Habermas’s work can be found in German and English. After the original year of publication and title, see the square brackets for the English translation. For some texts a translation does not exist, only exists in part, or is divided between texts. This is denoted by an asterisk (*).

• 1953. Mit Heidegger gegen Heidegger denken. Zur Veröffentlichung von Vorlesungen aus dem Jahre 1935. Frankfurter Allgemeine Zeitung. July 25, 1953. [English: 1977]
• 1956. Der Zerfall der Institutionen (Arnold Gehlen). Frankfurter Allgemeine Zeitung. July 4, 1956.*
• 1958. Philosopische Anthropologie: Ein Lexikonartikel. In: A. Diemer, I. Frenzel (eds.) Fischer-Lexikon Philosophie. Frankfurt am Main: Fischer. Pp. 18-35.*
• 1962. Strukturwandel derffentlichkeit. Darmstadt: Luchterhand. [English: 1989]
• 1967. Probleme einer philosophischen Anthropologie. Lecture transcript from the 1966/7 Winter semester at the University of Frankfurt (unauthorized edition).*
• 1967. Zur Logik der Sozialwissenschaften. Tübingen: J.C.B. Mohr. [English: 1988a]
• 1968a. Technik und Wissenschaft als Ideologie. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1970, 1973b*]
• 1968b. Erkenntnis und Interesse. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1971b]
• 1969. Protestbewegung und Hochschulreform. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English, 1970]
• 1970 Toward a Rational Society, J.J. Shapiro (trans.) Boston: Beacon.
• 1971a. Theorie und Praxis. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1973b]
• 1971b. Knowledge and Human Interests. J. J. Shapiro (trans.). Boston: Beacon.
• 1971c. The Christian Gauss Lectures: Reflections on the linguistic foundations of sociology [For published versions, see chapter 1 of German 1984b and pp.1-103 of English 2001* original translation for lecture purposes by Jeremy Shapiro; re-translated for publication by Barbara Fultner]
• 1973a. Wahrheitstheorien. In H. Fahrenbach (ed.), Wirklichkeit und Reflexion. Pfllingen: Neske. 211-265. Reprinted as chapter 2 in 1984b.*
• 1973b. Theory and Practice, J. Viertel (trans.). Boston: Beacon.
• 1973c. Nachwort / Postscript to Knowledge and Human Interests: Philosophy of the Social Sciences [included in all subsequent printings of Knowledge and Human Interests].
• 1973d. Legitimationsprobleme im Spätkapitalismus. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1975]
• 1975. Legitimation Crisis, T. McCarthy (trans.). Boston: Beacon.
• 1976a. Zur Rekonstruktion des Historischen Materialismus. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1979*]
• 1976b. Was heiβt Universalpragmatik? In K.-O. Apel (ed.), Sprachpragmatik und Philosophie. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. 174-272. [English: 1979, chap. 1]
• 1977. Martin Heidegger, on the publication of lectures from the year 1935. Graduate Faculty Philosophy Journal 6, no. 2: 155-180.
• 1979. Communication and the Evolution of Society, T. McCarthy (trans.) Boston: Beacon.
• 1981. Theorie des kommunikativen Handelns. Band I: Handlungsrationalität und gesellschaftliche Rationalisierung. Band II: Zur Kritik der funktionalistischen Vernunft. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1984a and 1987]
• 1983. Moralbewuβtsein und kommunikatives Handeln. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1990a]
• 1984a. The Theory of Communicative Action, Volume I: Reason and the Rationalization of Society, T. McCarthy (trans.). Boston: Beacon.
• 1984b. Vorstudien und Ergänzungen zur Theorie des kommunikativen Handelns. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2001* does not include the Wahrheitstheorien essay]
• 1985. Die Neue Unübersichtlichkeit: Kleine Politische Schriften V.ÿ Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1991]
• 1986a. Gerechtigkeit und Solidarität: Eine Stellungnahme zur Diskussion über Stufe 6. In W. Edelstein and G. Nunner-Winkler (eds), Zur Bestimmung der Moral. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. 291-318. [English: 1990b]
• 1986b. Entgegnung. In A. Honneth and H. Joas (eds), Kommunikatives Handeln. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. 327-405. [English: 1991b]
• 1987. The Theory of Communicative Action. Vol. II: Lifeworld and System, T. McCarthy (trans.). Boston: Beacon.
• 1988a. On the Logic of the Social Sciences, S. W. Nicholsen and J. A. Stark (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1988b. Nachmetaphysisches Denken. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1992a]
• 1989. The Structural Transformation of the Public Sphere, T. Burger and F. Lawrence (trans). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1990a. Moral Consciousness and Communicative Action, C. Lenhardt and S. W. Nicholsen (trans). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1990b. Justice and solidarity: On the discussion concerning stage 6. In: T. E. Wren (ed.), The Moral Domain. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. 224-251, S. W. Nicholsen (trans.).
• 1991a. Erläuterungen zur Diskursethik. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1993]
• 1991b. The New Conservatism: Cultural Criticism and the Historians’ Debate. S. W. Nicholsen (trans.).
• 1992a. Postmetaphysical Thinking, W. M. Hohengarten (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1992b. Faktizität und Geltung. Beiträge zur Diskurstheorie des Rechts und des demokratischen Rechtsstaats. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1996b]
• 1993. Justification and Application, C. P. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1994. The Past as Future. M. Pensky and P. Hohendahl (trans.). University of Nebraska Press.
• 1996a. Die Einbeziehung des Anderen. Studien zur politischen Theorie. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 1998a]
• 1996b. Between Facts and Norms: Contributions to a Discourse Theory of Law and Democracy, W. Rehg (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [German, 1992]
• 1998a. Inclusion of the Other: Studies in Political Theory, C. Cronin and P. DeGreiff (eds). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1998b. Die postnationale Konstellation. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2001a]
• 1999a. Wahrheit und Rechtfertigung. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2003a]
• 2001a. The Postnational Constellation, M. Pensky (trans., ed.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 2001b. Die Zukunft der menschlichen Natur. Auf dem Weg zu einer liberalen Eugenik? Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2003b]
• 2001c. Zeit der Übergänge. Kleine politische Schriften IX. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2004b]
• 2003a. Truth and Justification, B. Fultner (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 2003b. The Future of Human Nature, W. Rehg, M. Pensky, and H. Beister (trans.). Cambridge: Polity.
• 2004a. Der gespaltene Westen. Kleine politische Schriften X. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2006a]
• 2004b. Time of Transitions. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2006a. The Divided West. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2006b. Pre-political foundations of the democratic constitutional state. In J. Habermas and J. Ratzinger The Dialectics of Secularization: On Reasons and Religion. B. McNeil (trans.). San Francisco: Ignatius. 19-52.
• 2007. Kommunikative Vernunft und grenzüberschreitende Politik. Eine Replik. In: Anarchie der kommunikativen Freiheit Jürgen Habermas und die Theorie der internationalen Politik. Peter Niesen and Benjamin Herborth (eds.). Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Press.
• 2008. Between Naturalism and Religion. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2008. Ach Europa. Kleine politische Schriften XI. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp. [English: 2009]
• 2009. Europe: the Faltering Project. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2012: The Crisis of the European Union: A Response. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2014. The Lure of Technocracy. C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge: Polity Press.
• 2014. Entgegnung (x13) and Schlusswort. In: Habermas und der Historische Materialismus. Smail Rapic (ed.). München: Karl Alber Press.

d. Secondary Scholarship Beyond the Subject-Specific Recommendations Cited Above

• 1990. Apel, Karl-Otto. Diskurs und Verantwortung. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp.
• 2002. Apel, Karl-Otto. Regarding the relationship of morality, law and democracy: on Habermas’s Philosophy of Law (1992) from a transcendental-pragmatic point of view. In: Habermas and Pragmatism. Aboulafia, Mitchell, Myra Bookman and Catherine Kemp (eds.). 17-30.
• 2014. Brunkhorst, Hauke. Critical Theory of Legal Revolutions: Evolutionary Perspectives. Bloomsbury.
• 2009. Brunkhorst, Hauke, Regina Kreide and Cristina Lafont (eds.) Habermas-Handbuch. Stuttgart: JB Metzler.
• 2000b. Finlayson, James Gordon. What Are ‘Universalizable Interests’? Journal of Political Philosophy. vol. 8, no. 4, 456-469.
• 2004. Flynn, Jeffrey. Communicative Power in Habermas’s Theory of Democracy. European Journal of Political Theory, 433-454.
• 1993. Günther, Klaus. The Sense of Appropriateness. J. Farrell (trans.). Albany: SUNY Press.
• 1991. Honneth, Axel and Hans Joas. Communicative Action: Essays on Jürgen Habermas’s Theory of Communicative Action. Gaines, Jeremy and Doris L. Jones (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 2003. Horkheimer, Max and Theodor Adorno. Dialectic of Enlightenment. G. Schmid Noerr (ed.), E. Jephcott (trans.). Stanford: Stanford University Press.
• 2001. Joas, Hans. Values versus Norms: a pragmatic account of moral objectivity. In: The Hedgehog Review 3, 42-56.
• 2012. Lafont, Cristina. Agreement and Consent in Kant and Habermas: Can Kantian Constructivism be fruitful for democratic theory? In: The Philosophical Forum. 43/3, 277-95.
• 2009. Lafont, Cristina. Religion and the Public Sphere: What are the deliberative obligations of democratic citizenship? Philosophy and Social Criticism 35, 127-150.
• 1991. McCarthy, Thomas. Ideals and Illusions, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 2007. Müller, Jan-Werner. Constitutional Patriotism. Princeton University Press.
• 2000. Müller-Doohm, Stefan (ed.). Das Interesse der Vernunft: Rückblicke auf das Werk von Jürgen Habermas seit “Erkenntnis und Interesse”. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp.
• 2007. Niesen, Peter and Benjamin Herborth (eds.). Anarchie der kommunikativen Freiheit-Jürgen Habermas und die Theorie der internationalen Politik. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Press.
• 2002. Owen, David. Between Reason and History: Habermas and the Idea of Progress. Albany: SUNY Press.
• 2014. Rapic, Smail (ed.). Habermas und der Historische Materialismus. München: Karl Alber Press.
• 1989. Rockmore, Tom. Habermas and Historical Materialism. Bloomington and Indianapolis: Indiana University Press.
• 1998. Rosenfeld, Michel, and Andrew Arato (eds). Habermas on Law and Democracy, Berkeley: University of California Press.
• 1982. Thompson, John B. and David Held. Habermas: Critical Debates. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• 1991. Wellmer, Albrecht. Ethics and dialogue: Elements of moral judgment in Kant and discourse ethics. In: A. Wellmer, The Persistence of Modernity, D. Midgley (trans.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. 113-231.
• 1995. White, Stephen K. (ed.). The Cambridge Companion to Habermas. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• 2007. Yates, Melissa. Rawls and Habermas on religion in the public sphere. Philosophy and Social Criticism. 33, 880-891.

 

Author Information

Max Cherem
Email: Max.Cherem@kzoo.edu
Kalamazoo College
U. S. A.