Jules Henri Poincaré (1854—1912)

Poincaré was an influential French philosopher of science and mathematics, as well as a distinguished scientist and mathematician. In the foundations of mathematics he argued for conventionalism, against formalism, against logicism, and against Cantor’s treating his new infinite sets as being independent of human thinking. Poincaré stressed the essential role of intuition in a proper constructive foundation for mathematics. He believed that logic was a system of analytic truths, whereas arithmetic was synthetic and a priori, in Kant‘s sense of these terms. Mathematicians can use the methods of logic to check a proof, but they must use intuition to create a proof, he believed.

He maintained that non-Euclidean geometries are just as legitimate as Euclidean geometry, because all geometries are conventions or “disguised” definitions. Although all geometries are about physical space, a choice of one geometry over others is a matter of economy and simplicity, not a matter of finding the true one among the false ones.

For Poincaré, the aim of science is prediction rather than, say, explanation. Although every scientific theory has its own language or syntax, which is chosen by convention, it is not a matter of convention whether scientific predictions agree with the facts. For example, it is a matter of convention whether to define gravitation as following Newton’s theory of gravitation, but it is not a matter of convention as to whether gravitation is a force that acts on celestial bodies, or is the only force that does so. So, Poincaré believed that scientific laws are conventions but not arbitrary conventions.

Poincaré had an especially interesting view of scientific induction. Laws, he said, are not direct generalizations of experience; they aren’t mere summaries of the points on the graph. Rather, the scientist declares the law to be some interpolated curve that is more or less smooth and so will miss some of those points. Thus a scientific theory is not directly falsifiable by the data of experience; instead, the falsification process is more indirect.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Chaos and the Solar System
3. Arithmetic, Intuition and Logic
4. Conventionalism and the Philosophy of Geometry
5. Science and Hypothesis
6. Bibliography

1. Life

Poincaré was born on April 29,1854 in Nancy and died on July 17, 1912 in Paris. Poincaré’s family was influential. His cousin Raymond was the President and the Prime Minister of France, and his father Leon was a professor of medicine at the University of Nancy. His sister Aline married the spiritualist philosopher Emile Boutroux.

Poincaré studied mining engineering, mathematics and physics in Paris. Beginning in 1881, he taught at the University of Paris. There he held the chairs of Physical and Experimental Mechanics, Mathematical Physics and Theory of Probability, and Celestial Mechanics and Astronomy.

At the beginning of his scientific career, in his doctoral dissertation of1879, Poincaré devised a new way of studying the properties of functions defined by differential equations. He not only faced the question of determining the integral of such equations, but also was the first person to study the general geometric properties of these functions. He clearly saw that this method was useful in the solution of problems such as the stability of the solar system, in which the question is about the qualitative properties of planetary orbits (for example, are orbits regular or chaotic?) and not about the numerical solution of gravitational equations. During his studies on differential equations, Poincaré made use of Lobachevsky’s non-Euclidean geometry. Later, Poincaré applied to celestial mechanics the methods he had introduced in his doctoral dissertation. His research on the stability of the solar system opened the door to the study of chaotic deterministic systems; and the methods he used gave rise to algebraic topology.

Poincaré sketched a preliminary version of the special theory of relativity and stated that the velocity of light is a limit velocity and that mass depends on speed. He formulated the principle of relativity, according to which no mechanical or electromagnetic experiment can discriminate between a state of uniform motion and a state of rest, and he derived the Lorentz transformation. His fundamental theorem that every isolated mechanical system returns after a finite time [the Poincaré Recurrence Time] to its initial state is the source of many philosophical and scientific analyses on entropy. Finally, he clearly understood how radical is quantum theory’s departure from classical physics.

Poincaré was deeply interested in the philosophy of science and the foundations of mathematics. He argued for conventionalism and against both formalism and logicism. Cantor’s set theory was also an object of his criticism. He wrote several articles on the philosophical interpretation of mathematical logic. During his life, he published three books on the philosophy of science and mathematics. A fourth book was published posthumously in 1913.

2. Chaos and the Solar System

In his research on the three-body problem, Poincaré became the first person to discover a chaotic deterministic system. Given the law of gravity and the initial positions and velocities of the only three bodies in all of space, the subsequent positions and velocities are fixed–so the three-body system is deterministic. However, Poincaré found that the evolution of such a system is often chaotic in the sense that a small perturbation in the initial state such as a slight change in one body’s initial position might lead to a radically different later state than would be produced by the unperturbed system. If the slight change isn’t detectable by our measuring instruments, then we won’t be able to predict which final state will occur. So, Poincaré’s research proved that the problem of determinism and the problem of predictability are distinct problems.

From a philosophical point of view, Poincaré’s results did not receive the attention that they deserved. Also the scientific line of research that Poincaré opened was neglected until meteorologist Edward Lorenz, in 1963, rediscovered a chaotic deterministic system while he was studying the evolution of a simple model of the atmosphere. Earlier, Poincaré had suggested that the difficulties of reliable weather predicting are due to the intrinsic chaotic behavior of the atmosphere. Another interesting aspect of Poincaré’s study is the real nature of the distribution in phase space of stable and unstable points, which are so mixed that he did not try to make a picture of their arrangement. Now we know that the shape of such distribution is fractal-like. However, the scientific study of fractals did not begin until Benoit Mandelbrot’s work in 1975, a century after Poincaré’s first insight.

Why was Poincaré’s research neglected and underestimated? The problem is interesting because Poincaré was awarded an important scientific prize for his research; and his research in celestial mechanics was recognized to be of fundamental importance. Probably there were two causes. Scientists and philosophers were primarily interested in the revolutionary new physics of relativity and quantum mechanics, but Poincaré worked with classical mechanics. Also, the behavior of a chaotic deterministic system can be described only by means of a numerical solution whose complexity is staggering. Without the help of a computer the task is almost hopeless.

3. Arithmetic, Intuition and Logic

Logicists such as Bertrand Russell and Gottlob Frege believed that mathematics is basically a branch of symbolic logic, because they supposed that mathematical terminology can be defined using only the terminology of logic and because, after this translation of terms, any mathematical theorem can be shown to be a restatement of a theorem of logic. Poincaré objected to this logicist program. He was an intuitionist who stressed the essential role of human intuition in the foundations of mathematics. According to Poincaré, a definition of a mathematical entity is not the exposition of the essential properties of the entity, but it is the construction of the entity itself; in other words, a legitimate mathematical definition creates and justifies its object. For Poincaré, arithmetic is a synthetic science whose objects are not independent from human thought.

Poincaré made this point in his investigation of Peano’s axiomatization of arithmetic. Italian mathematician Giuseppe Peano (1858-1932) axiomatized the mathematical theory of natural numbers. This is the arithmetic of the nonnegative integers. Apart from some purely logical principles, Peano employed five mathematical axioms. Informally, these axioms are:

1. Zero is a natural number.
2. Zero is not the successor of any natural number.
3. Every natural number has a successor, which is a natural number.
4. If the successor of natural number a is equal to the successor of natural number b, then a and b are equal.
5. Suppose:
   (i) zero has a property P;
   (ii) if every natural number less than a has the property P then a also has the property P.
   Then every natural number has the property P. (This is the principle of complete induction.)

Bertrand Russell said Peano’s axioms constitute an implicit definition of natural numbers, but Poincaré said they do only if they can be demonstrated to be consistent. They can be shown consistent only by showing there is some object satisfying these axioms. From a general point of view, an axiom system can be conceived of as an implicit definition only if it is possible to prove the existence of at least one object that satisfies all the axioms. Proving this is not an easy task, for the number of consequences of Peano axioms is infinite and so a direct inspection of each consequence is not possible. Only one way seems adequate: we must verify that if the premises of an inference in the system are consistent with the axioms of logic, then so is the conclusion. Therefore, if after n inferences no contradiction is produced, then after n+1 inferences no contradiction will be either. Poincaré argues that this reasoning is a vicious circle, for it relies upon the principle of complete induction, whose consistency we have to prove. (In 1936, Gerhard Gentzen proved the consistency of Peano axioms, but his proof required the use of a limited form of transfinite induction whose own consistency is in doubt.) As a consequence, Poincaré asserts that if we can’t noncircularly establish the consistency of Peano’s axioms, then the principle of complete induction is surely not provable by means of general logical laws; thus it is not analytic, but it is a synthetic judgment, and logicism is refuted. It is evident that Poincaré supports Kant’s epistemological viewpoint on arithmetic. For Poincaré, the principle of complete induction, which is not provable via analytical inferences, is a genuine synthetic a priori judgment. Hence arithmetic cannot be reduced to logic; the latter is analytic, while arithmetic is synthetic.

The synthetic character of arithmetic is also evident if we consider the nature of mathematical reasoning. Poincaré suggests a distinction between two different kinds of mathematical inference: verification and proof. Verification or proof-check is a sort of mechanical reasoning, while proof-creation is a fecund inference. For example, the statement “2+2 = 4” is verifiable because it is possible to demonstrate its truth with the help of logical laws and the definition of sum; it is an analytical statement that admits a straightforward verification. On the contrary, the general statement (the commutative law of addition)

For any natural numbers x and y, x + y = y + x

is not directly verifiable. We can choose an arbitrary pair of natural numbers a and b, and we can verify that a+b = b+a; but there is an infinite number of admissible choices of pairs, so the verification is always incomplete. In other words, the verification of the commutative law is an analytical method by means of which we can verify every particular instance of a general theorem, but the proof of the theorem itself is synthetic reasoning which really extends our knowledge, Poincaré believed.

Another aspect of mathematical thinking that Poincaré analyzes is the different roles played by intuition and logic. Methods of formal logic are elementary and certain, and we can surely rely on them. However, logic does not teach us how to build a proof. It is intuition that helps mathematicians find the correct way to assemble basic inferences into a useful proof. Poincaré offers the following example. An unskilled chess player who watches a game can verify whether a move is legal, but he does not understand why players move certain pieces, for he does not see the plan which guides players’ choices. In a similar way, a mathematician who uses only logical methods can verify every inference in a given proof, but he cannot find an original proof. In other words, every elementary inference in a proof is easily verifiable through formal logic, but the invention of a proof requires the understanding — grasped by intuition — of the general scheme, which directs mathematician’s efforts towards the final goal.

Logic is — according to Poincaré — the study of properties which are common to all classifications. There are two different kinds of classifications: predicative classifications, which are not modified by the introduction of new elements; and impredicative classifications, which are modified by new elements. Definitions as well as classifications are divided into predicative and impredicative. A set is defined by a law according to which every element is generated. In the case of an infinite set, the process of generating elements is unfinished; thus there are always new elements. If their introduction changes the classification of already generated objects, then the definition is impredicative. For example, look at phrases containing a finite number of words and defining a point of space. These phrases are arranged in alphabetical order and each of them is associated with a natural number: the first is associated with number 1, the second with 2, etc. Hence every point defined by such phrases is associated with a natural number. Now suppose that a new point is defined by a new phrase. To determine the corresponding number it is necessary to insert this phrase in alphabetical order; but such an operation modifies the number associated with the already classified points whose defining phrase follows, in alphabetical order, the new phrase. Thus this new definition is impredicative.

For Poincaré, impredicative definitions are the source of antinomies in set theory, and the prohibition of impredicative definitions will remove such antinomies. To this end, Poincaré enunciates the vicious circle principle: a thing cannot be defined with respect to a collection that presupposes the thing itself. In other words, in a definition of an object, one cannot use a set to which the object belongs, because doing so produces an impredicative definition. Poincaré attributes the vicious circle principle to a French mathematician J. Richard. In 1905, Richard discovered a new paradox in set theory, and he offered a tentative solution based on the vicious circle principle.

Poincaré’s prohibition of impredicative definitions is also connected with his point of view on infinity. According to Poincaré, there are two different schools of thought about infinite sets; he called these schools Cantorian and Pragmatist. Cantorians are realists with respect to mathematical entities; these entities have a reality that is independent of human conceptions. The mathematician discovers them but does not create them. Pragmatists believe that a thing exists only when it is the object of an act of thinking, and infinity is nothing but the possibility of the mind’s generating an endless series of finite objects. Practicing mathematicians tend to be realists, not pragmatists or intuitionists. This dispute is not about the role of impredicative definitions in producing antinomies, but about the independence of mathematical entities from human thinking.

4. Conventionalism and the Philosophy of Geometry

The discovery of non-Euclidean geometries upset the commonly accepted Kantian viewpoint that the true structure of space can be known a priori. To understand Poincaré’s point of view on the foundation of geometry, it helps to remember that, during his research on functions defined by differential equations, he actually used non-Euclidean geometry. He found that several geometric properties are easily provable by means of Lobachevsky geometry, while their proof is not straightforward in Euclidean geometry. Also, Poincaré knew Beltrami’s research on Lobachevsky’s geometry. Beltrami (Italian mathematician, 1835-1899) proved the consistency of Lobachevsky geometry with respect to Euclidean geometry, by means of a translation of every term of Lobachevsky geometry into a term of Euclidean geometry. The translation is carefully chosen so that every axiom of non-Euclidean geometry is translated into a theorem of Euclidean geometry. Beltrami’s translation and Poincaré’s study of functions led Poincaré to assert that:

• Non-Euclidean geometries have the same logical and mathematical legitimacy as Euclidean geometry.
• All geometric systems are equivalent and thus no system of axioms may claim that it is the true geometry.
• Axioms of geometry are neither synthetic a priori judgments nor analytic ones; they are conventions or ‘disguised’ definitions.

According to Poincaré, all geometric systems deal with the same properties of space, although each of them employs its own language, whose syntax is defined by the set of axioms. In other words, geometries differ in their language, but they are concerned with the same reality, for a geometry can be translated into another geometry. There is only one criterion according to which we can select a geometry, namely a criterion of economy and simplicity. This is the very reason why we commonly use Euclidean geometry: it is the simplest. However, with respect to a specific problem, non-Euclidean geometry may give us the result with less effort. In 1915, Albert Einstein found it more convenient, the conventionalist would say, to develop his theory of general relativity using non-Euclidean rather than Euclidean geometry. Poincaré’s realist opponent would disagree and say that Einstein discovered space to be non-Euclidean.

Poincaré’s treatment of geometry is applicable also to the general analysis of scientific theories. Every scientific theory has its own language, which is chosen by convention. However, in spite of this freedom, the agreement or disagreement between predictions and facts is not conventional but is substantial and objective. Science has an objective validity. It is not due to chance or to freedom of choice that scientific predictions are often accurate.

These considerations clarify Poincaré’s conventionalism. There is an objective criterion, independent of the scientist’s will, according to which it is possible to judge the soundness of the scientific theory, namely the accuracy of its predictions. Thus the principles of science are not set by an arbitrary convention. In so far as scientific predictions are true, science gives us objective, although incomplete, knowledge. The freedom of a scientist takes place in the choice of language, axioms, and the facts that deserve attention.

However, according to Poincaré, every scientific law can be analyzed into two parts, namely a principle, that is a conventional truth, and an empirical law. The following example is due to Poincaré. The law:

Celestial bodies obey Newton’s law of gravitation

The law consists of two elements:

1. Gravitation follows Newton law.
2. Gravitation is the only force that acts on celestial bodies.

We can regard the first statement as a principle, as a convention; thus it becomes the definition of gravitation. But then the second statement is an empirical law.

Poincaré’s attitude towards conventionalism is illustrated by the following statement, which concluded his analysis on classical mechanics in Science and Hypothesis:

Are the laws of acceleration and composition of forces nothing but arbitrary conventions? Conventions, yes; arbitrary, no; they would seem arbitrary if we forgot the experiences which guided the founders of science to their adoption and which are, although imperfect, sufficient to justify them. Sometimes it is useful to turn our attention to the experimental origin of these conventions.

5. Science and Hypothesis

According to Poincaré, although scientific theories originate from experience, they are neither verifiable nor falsifiable by means of the experience alone. For example, look at the problem of finding a mathematical law that describes a given series of observations. In this case, representative points are plotted in a graph, and then a simple curve is interpolated. The curve chosen will depend both on the experience which determines the representative points and on the desired smoothness of the curve even though the smoother the curve the more that some points will miss the curve. Therefore, the interpolated curve — and thus the tentative law — is not a direct generalization of the experience, for it ‘corrects’ the experience. The discrepancy between observed and calculated values is thus not regarded as a falsification of the law, but as a correction that the law imposes on our observations. In this sense, there is always a necessary difference between facts and theories, and therefore a scientific theory is not directly falsifiable by the experience.

For Poincaré, the aim of the science is to prediction. To accomplish this task, science makes use of generalizations that go beyond the experience. In fact, scientific theories are hypotheses. But every hypothesis has to be continually tested. And when it fails in an empirical test, it must be given up. According to Poincaré, a scientific hypothesis which was proved untenable can still be very useful. If a hypothesis does not pass an empirical test, then this fact means that we have neglected some important and meaningful element; thus the hypothesis gives us the opportunity to discover the existence of an unforeseen aspect of reality. As a consequence of this point of view about the nature of scientific theories, Poincaré suggests that a scientist must utilize few hypotheses, for it is very difficult to find the wrong hypothesis in a theory which makes use of many hypotheses.

For Poincaré, there are many kinds of hypotheses:

• Hypotheses which have the maximum scope, and which are common to all scientific theories (for example, the hypothesis according to which the influence of remote bodies is negligible). Such hypotheses are the last to be changed.
• Indifferent hypotheses that, in spite of their auxiliary role in scientific theories, have no objective content (for example, the hypothesis that unseen atoms exist).
• Generalizations, which are subjected to empirical control; they are the true scientific hypotheses.

Regarding Poincaré’s point of view about scientific theories, the following have the most lasting value:

• Every scientific theory is a hypothesis that had to be tested.
• Experience suggests scientific theories; but experience does not justify them.
• Experience alone is unable to falsify a theory, for the theory often corrects the experience.
• A central aim of science is prediction.
• The role of a falsified hypothesis is very important, for it throws light on unforeseen conditions.
• Experience is judged according to a theory.

6. Bibliography

COLLECTED SCIENTIFIC WORKS (in French).

• Oeuvres, 11 volumes, Paris : Gauthier-Villars, 1916-1956

PHILOSOPHICAL WORKS.

• 1902 La science et l’hypothèse, Paris : Flammarion (Science and hypothesis, 1905)
• 1905 La valeur de la science, Paris : Flammarion (The value of science, 1907)
• 1908 Science and méthode, Paris : Flammarion (Science and method, 1914)
• 1913 Dernières pensées, Paris : Flammarion (Mathematics and science: last essays, 1963)
• The first three works are translated in The foundations of science, Washington, D.C. : University Press of America, 1982 (first edition 1946).

MAIN SCIENTIFIC WORKS.

• Les méthods nouvelles de la mécanique céleste, Paris : Gauthier-Villars, 1892 vol. I , 1893 vol. II, 1899 vol. III (New methods of celestial mechanics, American Institute of Physics, 1993)
• Lecons de mécanique céleste, Paris : Gauthier-Villars, 1905 vol. I, 1907 vol. II part I, 1909 vol. II part II, 1911 vol. III

WORKS ABOUT POINCARE’.

• Le livre du centenaire de la naissance de Henri Poincaré, Paris : Gauthier-Villars, 1955
• The mathematical heritage of Henri Poincaré, (edited by Felix E. Browder) Providence, R.I. : American Mathematical Society, 1983 [Symposium on the Mathematical Heritage of Henri Poincaré (1980 : Indiana University, Bloomington)]
• Henri Poincaré: Science et philosophie. Congrès international : Nancy, France, 1994, edited by Jean-Louis Greffe, Gerhard Heinzmann, Kuno Lorenz, Berlin : Akademie Verlag, 1996 ; Paris : A. Blanchard, 1996
• Appel, Paul, Henri Poincaré, Paris : Plon, 1925
• Bartocci, Claudio, “Equazioni e orbite celesti: gli albori della dinamica topologica” in Henri Poincaré. Geometria e caso, Torino : Bollati Boringhieri, 1995
• Barrow-Green, June, Poincaré and the three body problem, Providence, RI : American Mathematical Society ; London : London Mathematical Society, 1997
• Dantzig, Tobias, Henri Poincaré. Critic of crisis: reflections on his universe of discourse, New York : Scriber, 1954
• Folina, Janet, Poincaré and the philosophy of mathematics, London : Macmillan, 1992 ; New York : St. Martin’s Press, 1992
• Giedymin, Jerzy, Science and convention. Essay on Henri Poincaré’s philosophy of science and the conventionalist tradition, Oxford : Pergamon Press, 1982
• Heinzmann, Gerhard, Entre intuition et analyse : Poincaré et le concept de prédicativité, Paris : A. Blanchard, 1985
• Heinzmann, Gerhard, Zwischen Objektkonstruktion und Strukturanalyse. Zur Philosophie der Mathematik bei Poincaré, Vandenhoek & Ruprecht, 1995
• de Lorenzo, Javier, La filosofia de la matematica de Jules Henri Poincaré, Madrid : Editorial Tecnos, 1974
• Mette, Corinna, Invariantentheorie als Grundlage des Konventionalismus : Uberlegungen zur Wissenschaftstheorie von Poincaré , Essen : Die Blaue Eule, 1986, Essen, 1986
• Mooij, Jan, La philosophie des mathématiques de Henri Poincaré, Paris : Gauthier-Villars, 1966
• Parrini, Paolo, Empirismo logico e convenzionalismo, Milano : Franco Angeli, 1983
• Rougier, Luis, La philosophie géométrique de Henri Poincaré, Paris : Alcan, 1920
• Schmid, Anne-Francoise, Une philosophie de savant : Henri Poincaré et la logique mathématique, Paris : F. Maspero, 1978.
• Torretti, Roberto, Philosophy of geometry from Riemann to Poincaré, Dordrecth : D. Reidel Pub. Co., 1978

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Mauro Murzi
Email: murzim@yahoo.com
Italy