Adam Smith (1723—1790)
Adam Smith is often identified as the father of modern capitalism. While accurate to some extent, this description is both overly simplistic and dangerously misleading. On the one hand, it is true that very few individual books have had as much impact as his An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations. His accounts of the division of labor and free trade, self-interest in exchange, the limits on government intervention, price, and the general structure of the market, all signify the moment when economics transitions to the “modern.” On the other hand, The Wealth of Nations, as it is most often called, is not a book on economics. Its subject is “political economy,” a much more expansive mixture of philosophy, political science, history, economics, anthropology, and sociology. The role of the free market and the laissez-faire structures that support it are but two components of a larger theory of human interaction and social history.
Smith was not an economist; he was a philosopher. His first book, The Theory of Moral Sentiments, sought to describe the natural principles that govern morality and the ways in which human beings come to know them. How these two books fit together is both one of the most controversial subjects in Smith scholarship and the key to understanding his arguments about the market and human activity in general. Historically, this process is made more difficult by the so-called “Adam Smith Problem,” a position put forth by small numbers of committed scholars since the late nineteenth century that Smith’s two books are incompatible. The argument suggests that Smith’s work on ethics, which supposedly assumed altruistic human motivation, contradicts his political economy, which allegedly assumed egoism. However, most contemporary Smith scholars reject this claim as well as the description of Smith’s account of human motivation it presupposes.
Smith never uses the term “capitalism;” it does not enter into widespread use until the late nineteenth century. Instead, he uses “commercial society,” a phrase that emphasizes his belief that the economic is only one component of the human condition. And while, for Smith, a nation’s economic “stage” helps define its social and political structures, he is also clear that the moral character of a people is the ultimate measure of their humanity. To investigate Smith’s work, therefore, is to ask many of the great questions that we all struggle with today, including those that emphasize the relationship of morality and economics. Smith asks why individuals should be moral. He offers models for how people should treat themselves and others. He argues that scientific method can lead to moral discovery, and he presents a blueprint for a just society that concerns itself with its least well-off members, not just those with economic success. Adam Smith’s philosophy bears little resemblance to the libertarian caricature put forth by proponents of laissez faire markets who describe humans solely as homo economicus. For Smith, the market is a mechanism of morality and social support.
Table of Contents
- Life and Influences
- The Theory of Moral Sentiments
- An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations
- References and Further Reading
1. Life and Influences
a. Early Life and Influences
Adam Smith was born in June, 1723, in Kirkcaldy, a port town on the eastern shore of Scotland; the exact date is unknown. His father, the Comptroller and Collector of Customs, died while Smith’s mother was pregnant but left the family with adequate resources for their financial well being. Young Adam was educated in a local parish (district) school. In 1737, at the age of thirteen he was sent to Glasgow College after which he attended Baliol College at Oxford University. His positive experiences at school in Kirkcaldy and at Glasgow, combined with his negative reaction to the professors at Oxford, would remain a strong influence on his philosophy.
In particular, Smith held his teacher Francis Hutcheson in high esteem. One of the early leaders of the philosophical movement now called the Scottish Enlightenment, Hutcheson was a proponent of moral sense theory, the position that human beings make moral judgments using their sentiments rather than their “rational” capacities. According to Hutcheson, a sense of unity among human beings allows for the possibility of other-oriented actions even though individuals are often motivated by self-interest. The moral sense, which is a form of benevolence, elicits a feeling of approval in those witnessing moral acts. Hutcheson opposed ethical egoism, the notion that individuals ought to be motivated by their own interests ultimately, even when they cooperate with others on a common project.
The term “moral sense” was first coined by Sir Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of Shaftesbury, whose work Smith read and who became a focal point in the Scots’ discussion, although he himself was not Scottish. Although Shaftesbury did not offer a formal moral sense theory as Hutcheson did, he describes personal moral deliberation as a “soliloquy,” a process of self-division and self-examination similar in form to Hamlet’s remarks on suicide. This model of moral reasoning plays an important role in Smith’s books.
The Scottish Enlightenment philosophers, or the literati, as they called themselves, were a close-knit group who socialized together and who read, critiqued, and debated each other’s work. They met regularly in social clubs (often at pubs) to discuss politics and philosophy. Shortly after graduating from Oxford, Smith presented public lectures on moral philosophy in Edinburgh, and then, with the assistance of the literati, he secured his first position as the Chair of Logic at Glasgow University. His closest friendship in the group—and probably his most important non-familial relationship throughout his life—was with David Hume, an older philosopher whose work Smith was chastised for reading while at Oxford.
Hume was believed to be an atheist, and his work brought into question some of the core beliefs in moral philosophy. In particular, and even more so than Hutcheson, Hume’s own version of moral sense theory challenged the assumption that reason was the key human faculty in moral behavior. He famously asserted that reason is and ought to be slave to the passions, which means that even if the intellect can inform individuals as to what is morally correct, agents will only act if their sentiments incline them to do so. An old proverb tells us that you can lead a horse to water but that you can’t make it drink. Hume analogously argues that while you might be able to teach people what it means to be moral, only their passions, not their rational capacities, can actually inspire them to be ethical. This position has roots in Aristotle‘s distinction between moral and intellectual virtue.
Smith, while never explicitly arguing for Hume’s position, nonetheless seems to assume much of it. And while he does not offer a strict moral sense theory, he does adopt Hume’s assertion that moral behavior is, at core, the human capacity of sympathy, the faculty that, in Hume’s account, allows us to approve of others’ characters, to “forget our own interest in our judgments,” and to consider those whom “we meet with in society and conversation” who “are not placed in the same situation, and have not the same interest with ourselves” (Hume: Treatise, book 3.3.3).
b. Smith’s Writings
Smith echoes these words throughout A Theory of Moral Sentiments. In this book, he embraces Hume’s conception of sympathy, but rejects his skepticism and adds, as we shall see, a new theory of conscience to the mix. However, focusing on Hume’s observations also allow us to see certain other themes that Smith shares with his Scottish Enlightenment cohort: in particular, their commitment to empiricism. As with most of the other Scottish philosophers, Hume and Smith held that knowledge is acquired through the senses rather than through innate ideas, continuing the legacy of John Locke more so than René Descartes. For Hume, this epistemology would bring into question the connection between cause and effect—our senses, he argued, could only tell us that certain events followed one another in time, but not that they were causally related. For Smith, this meant a whole host of different problems. He asks, for example, how a person can know another’s sentiments and motivations, as well as how members can use the market to make “rational” decisions about the propriety of their economic activity.
At the core of the Scottish project is the attempt to articulate the laws governing human behavior. Smith and his contemporary Adam Ferguson are sometimes credited with being the founders of sociology because they, along with the other literati, believed that human activities were governed by discoverable principles in the same way that Newton argued that motion was explainable through principles. Newton, in fact, was a tremendous influence on the Scots’ methodology. In an unpublished essay on the history of astronomy, Smith writes that Newton’s system, had “gained the general and complete approbation of mankind,” and that it ought to be considered “the greatest discovery that ever was made by man.” What made it so important? Smith describes it as “the discovery of an immense chain of the most important and sublime truths, all closely connected together, by one capital fact, of the reality of which we have daily experience” (EPS, Astronomy IV.76).
While Smith held the chair of logic at Glasgow University, he lectured more on rhetoric than on traditional Aristotelian forms of reasoning. There is a collection of student lecture notes that recount Smith’s discussions of style, narrative, and moral propriety in rhetorical contexts. These notes, in combination with his essay on astronomy, offer an account of explanation that Smith himself regarded as essentially Newtonian. According to Smith, a theory must first be believable; it must soothe anxiety by avoiding any gaps in its account. Again, relying upon a basically Aristotelian model, Smith tells us that the desire to learn, and the theories that result, stems from a series of emotions: surprise at events inspires anxieties that cause one to wonder about the process. This leads to understanding and admiration of the acts and principles of nature. By showing that the principles governing the heavens also govern the Earth, Newton set a new standard for explanation. A theory must direct the mind with its narrative in a way that both corresponds with experience and offers theoretical accounts that enhance understanding and allow for prediction. The account must fit together systematically without holes or missing information; this last element—avoiding any gaps in the theory—is, perhaps, the most central element for Smith, and this model of philosophical explanation unifies both his moral theories and his political economy.
As a young philosopher, Smith experimented with different topics, and there is a collection of writing fragments to compliment his lecture notes and early essays. These include brief explorations of “Ancient Logics,” metaphysics, the senses, physics, aesthetics, the work of Jean-Jacque Rousseau, and other assorted topics. Smith’s Scottish Enlightenment contemporaries shared an interest in all of these issues.
While the works offer a glimpse into Smith’s meditations, they are by no means definitive; few of them were ever authorized for publication. Smith was a meticulous writer and, in his own words, “a slow a very slow workman, who do and undo everything I write at least half a dozen of times before I can be tolerably pleased with it” (Corr. 311). As a result, he ordered sixteen volumes of unpublished writing burnt upon his death because, presumably, he did not feel they were adequate for public consumption. Smith scholars lament this loss because it obfuscates the blueprint of his system, and there have been several attempts of late to reconstruct the design of Smith’s corpus, again with the intent of arguing for a particular relationship between his major works.
After holding the chair of logic at Glasgow for only one year (1751–1752), Smith was appointed to the Chair of Moral Philosophy, the position originally held by Hutcheson. He wrote The Theory of Moral Sentiments, first published in 1759, while holding this position and, presumably, while testing out many of his discussions in the classroom. While he spoke very warmly of this period of his life, and while he took a deep interest in teaching and mentoring young minds, Smith resigned in 1764 to tutor the Duke of Buccleuch and accompany him on his travels.
It was not uncommon for professional teachers to accept positions as private tutors. The salary and pensions were often lucrative, and it allowed more flexibility than a busy lecturing schedule might afford. In Smith’s case, this position took him to France where he spent two years engaged with the philosophes—a tight-knit group of French philosophers analogous to Smith’s own literati—in conversations that would make their way into The Wealth of Nations. How influential the philosophes were in the creation of Smith’s political economy is a matter of controversy. Some scholars suggest that Smith’s attitudes were formed as a result of their persuasion while others suggest that Smith’s ideas were solidified much earlier than his trip abroad. Whatever the case, this shows that Smith’s interests were aligned, not just with the Scottish philosophers, but with their European counterparts. Smith’s writing was well-received in part because it was so timely. He was asking the deep questions of the time; his answers would change the world.
After his travels, Smith returned to his home town of Kirkcaldy to complete The Wealth of Nations. It was first published in 1776 and was praised both by his friends and the general public. In a letter written much later, he referred to it as the “very violent attack I had made upon the whole commercial system of Great Britain” (Corr. 208). The Theory of Moral Sentiments went through six editions in Smith’s lifetime, two of which contained major substantive changes and The Wealth of Nations saw four different editions with more minor alterations. Smith indicated that he thought The Theory of Moral Sentiments was a better book, and his on-going attention to its details and adjustments to its theory bear out, at least, that he was more committed to refining it. Eventually, Smith moved to Edinburgh with his mother and was appointed commissioner of customs in 1778; he did not publish anything substantive for the remainder of his life. Adam Smith died on July 17, 1790.
After his death, The Wealth of Nations continued to grow in stature and The Theory of Moral Sentiments began to fade into the background. In the more than two centuries since his death, his published work has been supplemented by the discoveries of his early writing fragments, the student-authored lectures notes on his course in rhetoric and belles-letters, student-authored lecture notes on jurisprudence, and an early draft of part of The Wealth of Nations, the date of which is estimated to be about 1763. The latter two discoveries help shed light on the formulation of his most famous work and supply fodder for both sides of the debate regarding the influence of the philosophes on Smith’s political economy.
As stated above, Smith is sometimes credited with being one of the progenitors of modern sociology, and his lectures on rhetoric have also been called the blueprint for the invention of the modern discipline of English; this largely has to do with their influence on his student Hugh Blair, whose own lectures on rhetoric were instrumental in the formation of that discipline. The Theory of Moral Sentiments played an important role in 19th century sentimentalist literature and was also cited by Mary Wollstonecraft to bolster her argument in A Vindication of the Rights of Women: Smith’s moral theories experienced a revival in the last quarter of the twentieth century. Secondary sources on Smith flooded the marketplace and interest in Smith’s work as a whole has reached an entirely new audience.
There are two noteworthy characteristics of the latest wave of interest in Smith. The first is that scholars are interested in how The Theory of Moral Sentiments and The Wealth of Nations interconnect, not simply in his moral and economic theories as distinct from one another. The second is that it is philosophers and not economists who are primarily interested in Smith’s writings. They therefore pay special attention to where Smith might fit in within the already established philosophical canon: How does Smith’s work build on Hume’s? How does it relate to that of his contemporary Immanuel Kant? (It is known that Kant read The Theory of Moral Sentiments, for example.) To what extent is a sentiment-based moral theory defensible? And, what can one learn about the Scots and eighteenth-century philosophy in general from reading Smith in a historical context? These are but a few of the questions with which Smith’s readers now concern themselves.
2. The Theory of Moral Sentiments
a. Sympathy
Hutcheson, Hume, and Smith were unified by their opposition to arguments put forth by Bernard Mandeville. A Dutch-born philosopher who relocated to England, Mandeville argued that benevolence does no social good whatsoever. His book, The Fable of the Bees: Private Vices, Public Benefits, tells the whole story. Bad behavior has positive social impact. Without vice, we would have, for example, no police, locksmiths, or other such professionals. Without indulgence, there would be only minimal consumer spending. Virtue, on the other hand, he argued, has no positive economic benefit and is therefore not to be encouraged.
But Mandeville took this a step further, arguing, as did Thomas Hobbes, that moral virtue derives from personal benefit, that humans are essentially selfish, and that all people are in competition with one another. Hobbes was a moral relativist, arguing that “good” is just a synonym for “that which people desire.” Mandeville’s relativism, if it can be called that, is less extreme. While he argues that virtue is the intentional act for the good of others with the objective of achieving that good, he casts doubt on whether or not anyone could actually achieve this standard. Smith seems to treat both philosophers as if they argue for the same conclusion; both offer counterpoints to Shaftesbury’s approach. Tellingly, Mandeville writes wistfully of Shaftesbury’s positive accounts of human motivation, remarking they are “a high Compliment to Human-kind,” adding, however, “what Pity it is that they are not true” (Fable, I, 324).
Smith was so opposed to Hobbes’s and Mandeville’s positions that the very first sentence of The Theory of Moral Sentiments begins with their rejection:
However selfish man may be supposed, there are evidently some principles in his nature, which interest him in the fortune of others, and render their happiness necessary to him, though they derive nothing from it except the pleasure of seeing it. (TMS I.i.1.1)
While it is often assumed that people are selfish, Smith argues that experience suggests otherwise. People derive pleasure from seeing the happiness of others because, by design, others concern us. With this initial comment, Smith outlines the central themes of his moral philosophy: human beings are social, we care about others and their circumstances bring us pleasure or pain. It is only through our senses, through “seeing,” that we acquire knowledge of their sentiments. Smith’s first sentence associates egoism with supposition or presumption, but scientific “principles” of human activity are associated with evidence: Newtonianism and empiricism in action.
The Theory of Moral Sentiments (TMS) is a beautifully written book, clear and engaging. With few exceptions, the sentences are easy to follow, and it is written in a lively manner that speaks of its rehearsal in the classroom. Smith has a particular flair for examples, both literary and from day-to-day life, and his use of “we” throughout brings the reader into direct dialogue with Smith. The book feels like an accurate description of human emotions and experience—there are times when it feels phenomenological, although Smith would not have understood this word. He uses repetition to great benefit, reminding his readers of the central points in his theories while he slowly builds their complexity. At only 342 pages (all references are to the Glasgow Editions of his work), the book encompasses a tremendous range of themes. Disguised as a work of moral psychology—as a theory of moral sentiments alone—it is also a book about social organization, identity construction, normative standards, and the science of human behavior as a whole.
Smith tells us that the two questions of moral philosophy are “Wherein does virtue consist?” and “By what power or faculty in the mind is it, that this character, whatever it be, is recommended to us?” (TMS VII.i.2) In other words, we are to ask what goodness is and how we are to be good. The Theory of Moral Sentiments follows this plan, although Smith tackles the second question first, focusing on moral psychology long before he addresses the normative question of moral standards. For Smith, the core of moral learning and deliberation—the key to the development of identity itself—is social unity, and social unity is enabled through sympathy.
The term “sympathy” is Hume’s, but Smith’s friend gives little indication as to how it was supposed to work or as to its limits. In contrast, Smith addresses the problem head on, devoting the first sixty-six pages of TMS to illuminating its workings and most of the next two hundred elaborating on its nuances. The last part of the book (part VII, “Of Systems of Moral Philosophy”) is the most distanced from this topic, addressing the history of ethics but, again, only for slightly less than sixty pages. It is noteworthy that while modern writers almost always place the “literature review” in the beginning of their books, Smith feels that a historical discussion of ethics is only possible after the work on moral psychology is complete. This is likely because Smith wanted to establish the principles of human behavior first so that he could evaluate moral theory in the light of what had been posited.
The Theory of Moral Sentiments is, not surprisingly, both Aristotelian and Newtonian. It is also Stoic in its account of nature and self-command. The first sentence quoted above is a first principle—individuals are not egoistic—and all the rest of the book follows from this assertion. And, as with all first principles, while Smith “assumes” the possibility of other-oriented behavior, the rest of the book both derives from its truth and contributes to its believability. Smith’s examples, anecdotes, and hypotheticals are all quite believable, and if one is to accept these as accurate depictions of the human experience, then one must also accept his starting point. Human beings care for others, and altruism, or beneficence as he calls it, is possible.
What is sympathy, then? This is a matter of controversy. Scholars have regarded it as a faculty, a power, a process, and a feeling. What it is not, however, is a moral sense in the most literal meaning of the term. Sympathy is not a sixth capacity that can be grouped with the five senses. Smith, while influenced by Hutcheson, is openly critical of his teacher. He argues that moral sense without judgment is impossible (TMS VII.3.3.8-9), and sympathy is that which allows us to make judgments about ourselves and others. Sympathy is the foundation for moral deliberation, Smith argues, and Hutcheson’s system has no room for it.
For Smith, sympathy is more akin to modern empathy, the ability to relate to someone else’s emotions because we have experienced similar feelings. While contemporary “sympathy” refers only to feeling bad for a person’s suffering, Smith uses it to denote “fellow-feeling with any passion whatever” (TMS I.i.1.5). It is how a “spectator… changes places in fancy with… the person principally concerned” (TMS I.i.1.3-5).
In short, sympathy works as follows: individuals witness the actions and reactions of others. When doing so, this spectator attempts to enter into the situation he or she observes and imagines what it is like to be the actor—the person being watched. (Smith uses actor and agent interchangeably.) Then, the spectator imagines what he or she would do as the actor. If the sentiments match up, if the imagined reaction is analogous to the observed reaction, then the spectator sympathizes with the original person. If the reactions are significantly different, then the spectator does not sympathize with the person. In this context, then, sympathy is a form of moral approval and lack of sympathy indicates disapproval.
Sympathy is rarely exact. Smith is explicit that the imagined sentiments are always less intense than the original, but they are nonetheless close enough to signify agreement. And, most important, mutual sympathy is pleasurable. By nature’s design, people want to share fellow-feeling with one another and will therefore temper their actions so as to find common ground. This is further indication of the social nature of human beings; for Smith, isolation and moral disagreement is to be avoided. It is also the mechanism that moderates behavior. Behavior modulation is how individuals learn to act with moral propriety and within social norms. According to The Theory of Moral Sentiments, mutual sympathy is the foundation for reward and punishment.
Smith is insistent, though, that sympathy is not inspired by simply witnessing the emotions of others even though it “may seem to be transfused from one man to another, instantaneously, and antecedent to any knowledge of what excited them in the person principally concerned” (TMS I.i.1.6). Rather, the spectator gathers information about the cause of the emotions and about the person being watched. Only then does he or she ask, given the particular situation and the facts of this particular agent’s life, whether the sentiments are appropriate. As Smith writes:
When I condole with you for the loss of your only son, in order to enter into your grief I do not consider what I, a person of such a character and profession, should suffer, if I had a son, and if that son was unfortunately to die: but I consider what I should suffer if I was really you, and I not only change circumstance with you, but I change persons and characters. My grief, therefore, is entirely upon your own account, and not in the least upon my own. (TMS VI.iii.I.4)
We can see here why the imagination is so important to Smith. Only through this faculty can a person enter into the perspective of another, and only through careful observation and consideration can someone learn all the necessary information relevant to judge moral action. We can also see why sympathy is, for Smith, not an egoistic faculty:
In order to produce this concord, as nature teaches the spectators to assume the circumstances of the person principally concerned, so she teaches this last in some measure to assume those of the spectators. As they are continually placing themselves in his situation, and thence conceiving emotions similar to what he feels; so he is as constantly placing himself in theirs, and thence conceiving some degree of that coolness about his own fortune, with which he is sensible that they will view it. As they are constantly considering what they themselves would feel, if they actually were the sufferers, so he is as constantly led to imagine in what manner he would be affected if he was only one of the spectators of his own situation. As their sympathy makes them look at it, in some measure, with his eyes, so his sympathy makes him look at it, in some measure, with theirs, especially when in their presence and acting under their observation: and as the reflected passion, which he thus conceives, is much weaker than the original one, it necessarily abates the violence of what he felt before he came into their presence, before he began to recollect in what manner they would be affected by it, and to view his situation in this candid and impartial light. (TMS I.i.4.8)
Contrary to the description put forth by the Adam Smith Problem, sympathy cannot be either altruistic or egoistic because the agents are too intertwined. One is constantly making the leap from one point of view to another, and happiness and pleasure are dependant on joint perspectives. Individuals are only moral, and they only find their own happiness, from a shared standpoint. Egoism and altruism melt together for Smith to become a more nuanced and more social type of motivation that incorporates both self-interest and concern for others at the same time.
Typical of Smith, the lengthy paragraph cited above leads to at least two further qualifications. The first is that, as Smith puts it, “we expect less sympathy from a common acquaintance than from a friend… we expect still less sympathy from an assembly of strangers” (TMS I.1.4.10). Because sympathy requires information about events and people, the more distance we have from those around us, the more difficult it is for us to sympathize with their more passionate emotions (and vice versa). Thus, Smith argues, we are to be “more tranquil” in front of acquaintances and strangers; it is unseemly to be openly emotional around those who don’t know us. This will lead, eventually, to Smith’s discussion of duty in part III—his account of why we act morally towards those with whom we have no connection whatsoever.
The second qualification is more complex and revolves around the last phrase in the paragraph: that one must observe actions in a “candid and impartial light.” If movement toward social norms were the only component to sympathy, Smith’s theory would be a recipe for homogeneity alone. All sentiments would be modulated to an identical pitch and society would thereafter condemn only difference. Smith recognizes, therefore, that there must be instances in which individuals reject community judgment. They do so via the creation of an imagined impartial spectator.
b. The Impartial Spectator
Using the imagination, individuals who wish to judge their own actions create not just analogous emotions but an entire imaginary person who acts as observer and judge:
When I endeavour to examine my own conduct, when I endeavour to pass sentence upon it, and either to approve or condemn it, it is evident that, in all such cases, I divide myself, as it were, into two persons; and that I, the examiner and judge, represent a different character from that other I, the person whose conduct is examined into and judged of. The first is the spectator, whose sentiments with regard to my own conduct I endeavour to enter into, by placing myself in his situation, and by considering how it would appear to me, when seen from that particular point of view. The second is the agent, the person whom I properly call myself, and of whose conduct, under the character of a spectator, I was endeavouring to form some opinion. The first is the judge; the second the person judged of. But that the judge should, in every respect, be the same with the person judged of, is as impossible, as that the cause should, in every respect, be the same with the effect. (TMS III.1.6)
The impartial spectator is the anthropomorphization of the calm and disinterested self that can be recovered with self control and self reflection. In today’s world, someone might advise us to “take a deep breath and step back” from a given situation in order to reflect on our actions more dispassionately. Smith is suggesting the same, although he is describing it in more detail and in conjunction with the larger ethical theory that helps us find conclusions once we do so. Individuals who wish to judge their own actions imaginatively split themselves into two different people and use this bifurcation as a substitute for community observation.
Here we see the legacy of Shaftesbury’s soliloquy. An actor who wishes to gauge his or her own behavior has to divide him or herself in the way that Shaftesbury describes, in the way that Hamlet becomes both poet and philosopher. We are passionate about our own actions, and self-deception, according to Smith, is “the source of half the disorders of human life” (TMS III.4.6). Self-division gives individuals the ability to see themselves candidly and impartially and leads us to better self-knowledge. We strive to see ourselves the way others see us, but we do so while retaining access to the privileged personal information that others might not have. The community helps us see past our own biases, but when the community is limited by its own institutionalized bias or simply by lack of information, the impartial spectator can override this and allow an agent to find propriety in the face of a deformed moral system. In the contemporary world, racism and sexism are examples of insidious biases that prevent the community from “seeing” pain and injustice. Smith too can be read as recognizing these prejudices, although he would not have recognized either the terms or the complicated discourses about them that have evolved since he wrote two and a half centuries ago. For example, he cites slavery as an instance of the injustice and ignorance of a community. He writes:
There is not a Negro from the coast of Africa who does not, in this respect, possess a degree of magnanimity which the soul of his sordid master is too often scarce capable of conceiving. Fortune never exerted more cruelly her empire over mankind, than when she subjected those nations of heroes to the refuse of the jails of Europe, to wretches who possess the virtues neither of the countries which they come from, nor of those which they go to, and whose levity, brutality, and baseness, so justly expose them to the contempt of the vanquished. (TMS V.2.9)
Despite its corrective potential, impartiality has its limits. Smith does not imagine the impartial spectator to see from an Archimedean or God’s eye point of view. Because the impartial spectator does not really exist—because it is created by an individual person’s imagination—it is always subject to the limits of a person’s knowledge. This means that judgment will always be imperfect and those moral mistakes that are so profoundly interwoven into society or a person’s experience are the hardest to overcome. Change is slow and society is far from perfect. “Custom,” as he calls it, interferes with social judgment on both the collective and the individual level. There are two points, according to Smith, when we judge our own actions, before and after we act. As he writes, “Our views are apt to be very partial in both cases; but they are apt to be most partial when it is of most importance that they should be otherwise” (TMS 111.4.2). Neither of these points is independent of social influence.
Knowledge is imperfect and individuals do the best they can. But all individuals are limited both by their own experiences and the natural inadequacies of the human mind. Smith’s suggestion, then, is to have faith in the unfolding of nature, and in the principles that govern human activity—moral, social, economic, or otherwise. With this in mind, however, he cautions people against choosing the beauty of systems over the interest of people. Abstract philosophies and abstruse religions are not to take precedent over the evidence provided by experience, Smith argues. Additionally, social engineering is doomed to fail. Smith argues that one cannot move people around the way one moves pieces on a chess board. Each person has his or her “own principle of motion… different from that which the legislature might choose to impress upon” them (TMS VI.ii.2.18).
Smith’s caution against the love of systems is a component of Smith’s argument for limited government: “Harmony of minds,” Smith argues, is not possible without “free communication of settlements and opinion,” or, as we would call it today, freedom of expression (TMS VII.iv.27). It also offers a direct connection to Smith’s most famous phrase “the invisible hand.” In The Theory of Moral Sentiments, he uses the invisible hand to describe the conditions that allow for economic justice. This natural aesthetic love of systems leads people to manipulate the system of commerce, but this interferes with nature’s plan:
The rich only select from the heap what is most precious and agreeable. They consume little more than the poor, and in spite of their natural selfishness and rapacity, though they mean only their own conveniency, though the sole end which they propose from the labours of all the thousands whom they employ, be the gratification of their own vain and insatiable desires, they divide with the poor the produce of all their improvements. They are led by an invisible hand to make nearly the same distribution of the necessaries of life, which would have been made, had the earth been divided into equal portions among all its inhabitants, and thus without intending it, without knowing it, advance the interest of the society, and afford means to the multiplication of the species. (TMS IV.1.10)
In this passage, Smith argues that “the capacity of [the rich person’s] stomach bars no proportion to the immensity of his desires, and will receive no more than that of the meanest peasant” (TMS IV.1.10). Thus, because the rich only select “the best” and because they can only consume so much, there ought to be enough resources for everyone in the world, as if an invisible hand has divided the earth equally amongst all its inhabitants.
As an economic argument, this might have been more convincing in Smith’s time, before refrigeration, the industrial revolution, modern banking practices, and mass accumulation of capital; for a more thorough defense (from Smith’s point of view) see the discussion of The Wealth of Nations. However, its relevance to the history of economics is based upon his recognition of the role of unintended consequences, the presumption that economic growth helps all members of the society, and the recognition of the independence of the free market as a natural force. At present, we can focus on Smith’s warnings about the power of aesthetic attraction. The Newtonian approach, Smith argues—the search for a coherent narrative without gaps that addresses surprise, wonder, and admiration—can lead people astray if they prioritize beauty over the evidence. This love of the beautiful can also deform moral judgments because it causes the masses to over-value the rich, to think the wealthy are happy with their “baubles and trinkets,” and thus to pursue extreme wealth at the cost of moral goodness: “To attain to this envied situation, the candidates for fortune too frequently abandon the paths of virtue; for unhappily, the road which leads to the one and that which leads to the other, lie sometimes in very opposite directions” (TMS I.iii.8). Smith is very critical not only of the rich, but of the moral value society places on them. Only their wealth makes them different, and this love of wealth, and of beauty in general, can distort moral judgment and deform the impartial spectator.
The impartial spectator is a theory of conscience. It provides individuals with the opportunity to assent to their own standards of judgment, which, hopefully, are in general agreement with the standards of the society that houses them. Difference, as Smith discusses in both of his books, is the product of education, economic class, gender, what we would now call ethnic background, individual experience, and natural abilities; but Smith argues that the last of these, natural abilities, constitute the least of the factors. In his Lectures on Jurisprudence, for example, he argues that there is no “original difference” between individuals (LJ(A) vi.47-48), and in The Wealth of Nations, he writes that “The difference of natural talents in different men is, in reality, much less than we are aware of…. The difference between the most dissimilar characters, between a philosopher and a street porter, for example, seems to arise not so much from nature, as from habit, custom and education” (WN I.ii.4). Society and education, hopefully, help to bridge these gaps, and help to cultivate a unified community where people are encouraged to sympathize with others.
Here is the overlap in Smith’s two operative questions. First, one encounters his account of moral psychology. (How does one come to know virtue?) Now one comes face to face with the identification of moral standards themselves. (Of what does virtue consist?) Smith may look like a relativist at times: individuals modulate their sentiments to their community standards, and agreement of individual imaginations may falsely seem to be the final arbiter of what is morally appropriate behavior. With this in mind, there are certainly readers who will argue that Smith, despite his rejection of Hobbes and Mandeville, ends up offering no universally binding moral principles. This, however, forgets Smith’s Newtonian approach: observation leads to the discovery of natural principles that can be repeatedly tested and verified. Furthermore, many scholars argue that Smith was strongly influenced by the classical Stoics. In addition to inheriting their concern with the modulation of emotions and the repression of emotions in public, he also likely thought that moral laws are written into nature’s design in just the same way that Newton’s laws of motion are. As a result, some Smith scholars (but certainly not all) argue that Smith is a moral realist, that sympathy is a method of discovery rather than invention, and that what is to be discovered is correct independent of the opinions of those who either know or are ignorant of the rules.
Consistent with this interpretation, Smith emphasizes what he terms the general rules of morality:
…they are ultimately founded upon experience of what, in particular instances, our moral faculties, our natural sense of merit and propriety, approve, or disapprove of. We do not originally approve or condemn particular actions; because, upon examination, they appear to be agreeable or inconsistent with a certain general rule. The general rule, on the contrary, is formed, by finding from experience, that all actions of a certain kind, or circumstanced in a certain manner, are approved or disapproved of. To the man who first saw an inhuman murder, committed from avarice, envy, or unjust resentment, and upon one too that loved and trusted the murderer, who beheld the last agonies of the dying person, who heard him, with his expiring breath, complain more of the perfidy and ingratitude of his false friend, than of the violence which had been done to him, there could be no occasion, in order to conceive how horrible such an action was, that he should reflect, that one of the most sacred rules of conduct was what prohibited the taking away the life of an innocent person, that this was a plain violation of that rule, and consequently a very blamable action. His detestation of this crime, it is evident, would arise instantaneously and antecedent to his having formed to himself any such general rule. The general rule, on the contrary, which he might afterwards form, would be founded upon the detestation which he felt necessarily arise in his own breast, at the thought of this, and every other particular action of the same kind. (TMS III.4.8)
According to Smith, our sentiments give rise to approval or condemnation of a moral act. These can be modified over time with additional information. Eventually, though, spectators, see patterns in the condemnation. They see, for example, that murder is always wrong, and therefore derive a sense that this is a general rule. They begin, then, to act on the principle rather than on the sentiment. They do not murder, not simply because they detest murder, but because murder is wrong in itself. This, again, is Aristotelian in that it recognizes the interaction between intellectual and moral virtue. It also shares commonalities with the Kantian deontology that became so influential several decades after the publication of TMS. Like Kant, Smith’s agents begin to act on principle rather than emotion. Unlike Kant, however, reason in itself does not justify or validate the principle, experience does.
Smith does several things in the last excerpt. First, he embraces the Newtonian process of scientific experimentation and explanation. Moral rules are akin to the laws of physics; they can be discovered. Second, Smith anticipates Karl Popper’s twentieth-century claim that scientific truths are established through a process of falsification: we cannot prove what is true, Popper argued. Instead, we discover what is false and rule it out.
c. Virtues, Duty, and Justice
Smith emphasizes a number of virtues along with duty and justice. Self-command, he argues “is not only itself a great virtue, but from it all the other virtues seem to derive their principle lustre” (TMS VI.iii.11). This should not be surprising since, for Smith, it is only through self-command that agents can modulate their sentiments to the pitch required either by the community or the impartial spectator. Self-command is necessary because “the disposition to anger, hatred, envy, malice, [and] revenge… drive men from one another,” while “humanity, kindness, natural affection, friendship, [and] esteem… tend to unite men in society” (TMS VI.iii.15). One can see, then, the normative content of Smith’s virtues—those sentiments that are to be cultivated and those that are to be minimized. According to Smith, humans have a natural love for society and can develop neither moral nor aesthetic standards in isolation.
Individuals have a natural desire not only be to be loved, but to be worthy of love: “He desires not only praise, but praiseworthiness,… he dreads not only blame, but blame-worthiness” (TMS III.2.2). This speaks first to the power of the impartial spectator who is a guide to worth when no spectators are around. It also speaks to Smith’s conception of duty, in that it sets a standard of right action independent of what communities set forth. Individuals “derive no satisfaction” from unworthy praise (TMS III.2.5), and doing so is an indication of the perversion of vanity than can be corrected by seeing ourselves the way others would, if they knew the whole story.
It should not be surprising that Smith addresses God amidst his discussion of duty:
The all-wise Author of Nature has, in this manner, taught man to respect the sentiments and judgments of his brethren; to be more or less pleased when they approve of his conduct, and to be more or less hurt when they disapprove of it. He has made man, if I may say so, the immediate judge of mankind; and has, in this respect, as in many others, created him after his own image, and appointed him his vicegerent upon earth, to superintend the behaviour of his brethren. They are taught by nature, to acknowledge that power and jurisdiction which has thus been conferred upon him, to be more or less humbled and mortified when they have incurred his censure, and to be more or less elated when they have obtained his applause. (TMS III.2.31)
Here Smith makes several points. First, like many of the Scots, as well as Thomas Jefferson and many of the American founders, Smith was a deist. While there is controversy amongst scholars about the extent to which God is necessary to Smith’s theory, it is likely that he believed that God designed the universe and its rules, and then stepped back as it unfolded. Smith’s God is not an interventionist God and, despite some readers suggesting the contrary, the invisible hand is not an indication of God’s involvement in creation. It is, instead, just the unfolding of sociological and economic principles. Second, because God is detached from the system, Smith argues that human beings are God’s regents on earth. It is up to them to be the judges of their own behavior. Individuals are necessarily most concerned with themselves first, and are therefore best self-governed. Only then can they judge others via the moral system Smith describes. While it is true that, as Smith puts it, the general rules are “justly regarded as the laws of the deity” (TMS III.v), this seems to be a point of motivation, not of metaphysical assertion. If individuals understand the general rules as stemming from God, then they will follow them with more certainty and conviction. “The terrors of religion should thus enforce the natural sense of duty” (TMS III.5.7), Smith writes, because it inspires people to follow the general rules even if they are inclined not to do so, and because this support makes religion compatible with social and political life. Religious fanaticism, as Smith points out in The Wealth of Nations, is one of the great causes of factionalism—the great enemy of political society.
For Smith, the most precise virtue is justice. It is “the main pillar that upholds the whole edifice” of society (TMS III.ii.4). It is, as he describes it, “a negative virtue” and the minimal condition for participation in the community. Obeying the rules of justice, therefore, result in little praise, but breaking them inspires great condemnation:
There is, no doubt, a propriety in the practice of justice, and it merits, upon that account, all the approbation which is due to propriety. But as it does no real positive good, it is entitled to very little gratitude. Mere justice is, upon most occasions, but a negative virtue, and only hinders us from hurting our neighbour. The man who barely abstains from violating either the person, or the estate, or the reputation of his neighbours, has surely very little positive merit. He fulfils, however, all the rules of what is peculiarly called justice, and does every thing which his equals can with propriety force him to do, or which they can punish him for not doing. We may often fulfil all the rules of justice by sitting still and doing nothing. (TMS II.ii.1.9)
Smith’s account of justice assumes that individual rights and safety are core concerns. He writes:
The most sacred laws of justice, therefore, those whose violation seems to call loudest for vengeance and punishment, are the laws which guard the life and person of our neighbour; the next are those which guard his property and possessions; and last of all come those which guard what are called his personal rights, or what is due to him from the promises of others. (TMS II.ii.2.3)
His discussion of justice is supplemented in The Wealth of Nations and would have likely been added to in his proposed work on “the general principles of law and government” that he never completed. His lectures on jurisprudence give one a hint as to what might have been in that work, but one must assume that the manuscript was part of the collection of works burnt upon his death. (It is not even known what was actually destroyed, let alone what the works argued.) It is frustrating for Smith’s readers to have such gaps in his theory, and Smith scholars have debated the possible content of his other work and the way it relates to his first book. It is clear, though, that The Theory of Moral Sentiments is only one part of Smith’s larger system, and one truly understands it only in light of his other writing. It is therefore necessary to switch the discussion from his work on moral philosophy to his political economy. As will be evident, this break is not a radical one. The two books are entirely compatible with one another and reading one supplements reading the other; both contain moral claims and both make assertions classified as political economy. While their emphases are different much of the time—they are two different books after all—their basic points are more than just harmonious. They depend upon one another for justification.
3. An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations
a. Wealth and Trade
The Wealth of Nations (WN) was published in March of 1776, four months before the signing of the American Declaration of Independence. It is a much larger book than The Theory of Moral Sentiments—not counting appendices and indices, it runs 947 pages. To the first time reader, therefore, it may seem more daunting than Smith’s earlier work, but in many ways, it is actually a simpler read. As he grew older, Smith’s writing style became more efficient and less flowery, but his authorial voice remained conversational. His terms are more strictly defined in WN than in TMS, and he clearly identifies those positions he supports and rejects. His economic discussions are not as layered as his comments on morality, so the interpretive issues are often less complex. The logic of the book is transparent: its organizational scheme is self-explanatory, and its conclusions are meticulously supported with both philosophical argument and economic data. There are many who challenge its assertions, of course, but it is hard to deny that Smith’s positions in WN are defensible even if, in the end, some may conclude that he is wrong.
The text is divided into five “books” published in one, two, or three bound volumes depending on the edition. The first books outline the importance of the division of labor and of self-interest. The second discusses the role of stock and capital. The third provides an historical account of the rise of wealth from primitive times up until commercial society. The fourth discusses the economic growth that derives from the interaction between urban and rural sectors of a commercial society. The fifth and final book presents the role of the sovereign in a market economy, emphasizing the nature and limits of governmental powers and the means by which political institutions are to be paid for. Smith, along with his Scottish Enlightenment contemporaries, juxtaposes different time periods in order to find normative guidance. As TMS does, The Wealth of Nations contains a philosophy of history that trusts nature to reveal its logic and purpose.
This is a remarkable scope, even for a book of its size. Smith’s achievement, however, is not simply the multitude of his discussions, but how he makes it all fit together. His most impressive accomplishment in The Wealth of Nations is the presentation of a system of political economy. Smith makes seemingly disparate elements interdependent and consistent. He manages to take his Newtonian approach and create a narrative of both power and beauty, addressing the philosophical along with the economic, describing human behavior and history, and prescribing the best action for economic and political betterment. And, he does so building on a first principle that was at least as controversial as the sentence that began The Theory of Moral Sentiments. He begins the introduction by asserting:
The annual labour of every nation is the fund which originally supplies it with all the necessaries and conveniencies of life which it annually consumes, and which consist always either in the immediate produce of that labour, or in what is purchased with that produce from other nations. (WN intro.1)
The dominant economic theory of Smith’s time was mercantilism. It held that the wealth of a nation was to be assessed by the amount of money and goods within its borders at any given time. Smith calls this “stock.” Mercantilists sought to restrict trade because this increased the assets within the borders which, in turn, were thought to increase wealth. Smith opposed this, and the sentence cited above shifted the definition of national wealth to a different standard: labor.
The main point of The Wealth of Nations is to offer an alternative to mercantilism. Labor brings wealth, Smith argues. The more one labors the more one earns. This supplies individuals and the community with their necessities, and, with enough money, it offers the means to make life more convenient and sometimes to pursue additional revenue. Free trade, Smith argues, rather than diminishing the wealth of the nation, increases it because it provides more occasion for labor and therefore more occasion to create more wealth. Limited trade keeps the amount of wealth within the borders relatively constant, but the more trade a country engages in, the wider the market becomes and the more potential there is for additional labor and, in turn, additional wealth. This point leads Smith to divide stock into two parts, that which is used for immediate consumption—the assets that allow a person to acquire necessities—and that which is used to earn additional revenue. This latter sum he calls “capital” (WN II.1.2), and the term “capitalism” (which, again, Smith does not use) is derived from its use in a commercial system: capital is specifically earmarked for reinvestment and is therefore a major economic engine.
This is, of course, a philosophical point as much as an economic one: Smith asks his readers to reconsider the meaning of wealth itself. Is wealth the money and assets that one has at any given time, or is it these things combined with the potential to have more, to adjust to circumstances, and to cultivate the skills to increase such potential? Smith thinks it is the latter. Smith is also concerned specifically with the distinction between necessities and conveniences. His overarching concern in The Wealth of Nations is the creation of “universal opulence which extends itself to the lowest ranks of the people” (WN I.i.10). In other words, Smith believes that a commercial system betters the lives for the worst off in society; all individuals should have the necessities needed to live reasonably well. He is less concerned with “conveniences” and “luxuries;” he does not argue for an economically egalitarian system. Instead, he argues for a commercial system that increases both the general wealth and the particular wealth of the poorest members. He writes:
Is this improvement in the circumstances of the lower ranks of the people to be regarded as an advantage or as an inconveniency to the society? The answer seems at first sight abundantly plain. Servants, labourers and workmen of different kinds, make up the far greater part of every great political society. But what improves the circumstances of the greater part can never be regarded as an inconveniency to the whole. No society can surely be flourishing and happy, of which the far greater part of the members are poor and miserable. It is but equity, besides, that they who feed, cloath and lodge the whole body of the people, should have such a share of the produce of their own labour as to be themselves tolerably well fed, cloathed and lodged. (WN I.viii.36)
Smith argues that the key to the betterment of the masses is an increase in labor, productivity, and workforce. There are two main factors that influence this: “the skill, dexterity, and judgment with which its labour is generally applied,” and “the proportion between the number of those who are employed in useful labour, and that of those who are not” (WN intro.3).
Smith repeats the phrase “skill, dexterity and judgment” in the first paragraph of the body of the book, using it to segue into a discussion of manufacture. Famously, he uses the division of labor to illustrate the efficiency of workers working on complementary specific and narrow tasks. Considering the pin-maker, he suggests that a person who was required to make pins by him or herself could hardly make one pin per day, but if the process were divided into a different task for different people—”one man draws out the wire, another straights it, a third cuts it, a fourth points it, a fifth grinds it at the top for receiving the head; to make the head requires two or three distinct operations; to put it on, is a peculiar business, to whiten the pins is another”—then the factory could make approximately forty-eight thousand pins per day (WN I.i.3).
The increase in efficiency is also an increase in skill and dexterity, and brings with it a clarion call for the importance of specialization in the market. The more focused a worker is on a particular task the more likely they are to create innovation. He offers the following example:
In the first fire-engines, a boy was constantly employed to open and shut alternately the communication between the boiler and the cylinder, according as the piston either ascended or descended. One of those boys, who loved to play with his companions, observed that, by tying a string from the handle of the valve which opened this communication, to another part of the machine, the valve would open and shut without his assistance, and leave him at liberty to divert himself with his play-fellows. One of the greatest improvements that has been made upon this machine, since it was first invented, was in this manner the discovery of a boy who wanted to save his own labour. (WN I.i.8)
This example of a boy looking to ease his work day, illustrates two separate points. The first is the discussion at hand, the importance of specialization. In a commercial society, Smith argues, narrow employment becomes the norm: “Each individual becomes more expert in his own peculiar branch, more work is done upon the whole, and the quantity of science is considerably increased by it” (WN I.i.9). However, the more important point—certainly the more revolutionary one—is the role of self-interest in economic life. A free market harnesses personal desires for the betterment not of individuals but of the community.
Echoing but tempering Mandeville’s claim about private vices becoming public benefits, Smith illustrates that personal needs are complementary and not mutually exclusive. Human beings, by nature, have a “propensity to truck, barter, and exchange one thing for another” (WN I.ii.1). This tendency, which Smith suggests may be one of the “original principles in human nature,” is common to all people and drives commercial society forward. In an oft-cited comment, Smith observes,
It is not from the benevolence of the butcher, the brewer, or the baker, that we expect our dinner, but from their regard to their own self-interest. We address ourselves, not to their humanity but to their self-love, and never talk to them of our own necessities but of their advantages. (WN I.ii.2)
Philosophically, this is a tectonic shift in moral prescription. Dominant Christian beliefs had assumed that any self-interested action was sinful and shameful; the ideal person was entirely focused on the needs of others. Smith’s commercial society assumes something different. It accepts that the person who focuses on his or her own needs actually contributes to the public good and that, as a result, such self-interest should be cultivated.
Smith is not a proponent of what would today be called rampant consumerism. He is critical of the rich in both of his books. Instead, his argument is one that modern advocates of globalization and free trade will find familiar: when individuals purchase a product, they help more people than they attempted to do so through charity. He writes:
Observe the accommodation of the most common artificer or day-labourer in a civilized and thriving country, and you will perceive that the number of people of whose industry a part, though but a small part, has been employed in procuring him this accommodation, exceeds all computation. The woollen coat, for example, which covers the day-labourer, as coarse and rough as it may appear, is the produce of the joint labour of a great multitude of workmen. The shepherd, the sorter of the wool, the wool-comber or carder, the dyer, the scribbler, the spinner, the weaver, the fuller, the dresser, with many others, must all join their different arts in order to complete even this homely production. How many merchants and carriers, besides, must have been employed in transporting the materials from some of those workmen to others who often live in a very distant part of the country! how much commerce and navigation in particular, how many ship-builders, sailors, sail-makers, rope-makers, must have been employed in order to bring together the different drugs made use of by the dyer, which often come from the remotest corners of the world! What a variety of labour too is necessary in order to produce the tools of the meanest of those workmen! To say nothing of such complicated machines as the ship of the sailor, the mill of the fuller, or even the loom of the weaver, let us consider only what a variety of labour is requisite in order to form that very simple machine, the shears with which the shepherd clips the wool. The miner, the builder of the furnace for smelting the ore, the feller of the timber, the burner of the charcoal to be made use of in the smelting-house, the brick-maker, the brick-layer, the workmen who attend the furnace, the mill-wright, the forger, the smith, must all of them join their different arts in order to produce them. Were we to examine, in the same manner, all the different parts of his dress and household furniture, the coarse linen shirt which he wears next his skin, the shoes which cover his feet, the bed which he lies on, and all the different parts which compose it, the kitchen-grate at which he prepares his victuals, the coals which he makes use of for that purpose, dug from the bowels of the earth, and brought to him perhaps by a long sea and a long land carriage, all the other utensils of his kitchen, all the furniture of his table, the knives and forks, the earthen or pewter plates upon which he serves up and divides his victuals, the different hands employed in preparing his bread and his beer, the glass window which lets in the heat and the light, and keeps out the wind and the rain, with all the knowledge and art requisite for preparing that beautiful and happy invention, without which these northern parts of the world could scarce have afforded a very comfortable habitation, together with the tools of all the different workmen employed in producing those different conveniencies; if we examine, I say, all these things, and consider what a variety of labour is employed about each of them, we shall be sensible that without the assistance and co-operation of many thousands, the very meanest person in a civilized country could not be provided, even according to what we very falsely imagine, the easy and simple manner in which he is commonly accommodated. Compared, indeed, with the more extravagant luxury of the great, his accommodation must no doubt appear extremely simple and easy; and yet it may be true, perhaps, that the accommodation of an European prince does not always so much exceed that of an industrious and frugal peasant, as the accommodation of the latter exceeds that of many an African king, the absolute master of the lives and liberties of ten thousand naked savages. (WN I.i.11)
The length of this excerpt is part of its argumentative power. Smith is not suggesting, simply, that a single purchase benefits a group of people. Instead, he is arguing that once you take seriously the multitude of people whose income is connected to the purchase of the single coat, it is hard to even grasp the numbers we are considering. A single purchase brings with it a vast network of laborers. Furthermore, he argues, while one may be critical of the inevitable class difference of a commercial society, the differential is almost inconsequential compared to the disparity between the “haves” and “have-nots” in a feudal or even the most primitive societies. (Smith’s reference to “a thousand naked savages” is just thoughtless eighteenth century racism and can be chalked-up to the rhetoric of the time. It ought to be disregarded and has no impact on the argument itself.) It is the effect of one minor purchase on the community of economic agents that allows Smith to claim, as he does in TMS, that the goods of the world are divided equally as if by an invisible hand. For Smith, the wealthy can purchase nothing without benefiting the poor.
According to The Wealth of Nations, the power of the woolen coat is the power of the market at work, and its reach extends to national economic policy as well as personal economic behavior. Smith’s comments relate to his condemnation of social engineering in The Theory of Moral Sentiments, and he uses the same metaphor—the invisible hand—to condemn those mercantilists who think that by manipulating the market, they can improve the lot of individual groups of people.
But the annual revenue of every society is always precisely equal to the exchangeable value of the whole annual produce of its industry, or rather is precisely the same thing with that exchangeable value. As every individual, therefore, endeavours as much as he can both to employ his capital in the support of domestic industry, and so to direct that industry that its produce may be of the greatest value; every individual necessarily labours to render the annual revenue of the society as great as he can. He generally, indeed, neither intends to promote the public interest, nor knows how much he is promoting it. By preferring the support of domestic to that of foreign industry, he intends only his own security; and by directing that industry in such a manner as its produce may be of the greatest value, he intends only his own gain, and he is in this, as in many other cases, led by an invisible hand to promote an end which was no part of his intention. Nor is it always the worse for the society that it was no part of it. By pursuing his own interest he frequently promotes that of the society more effectually than when he really intends to promote it. I have never known much good done by those who affected to trade for the public good. It is an affectation, indeed, not very common among merchants, and very few words need be employed in dissuading them from it. (WN IV.2.9)
Smith begins his comments here with a restatement of the main point of The Wealth of Nations: “…the annual revenue of every society is always precisely equal to the exchangeable value of the whole annual produce of its industry, or rather is precisely the same thing with that exchangeable value.” The income of any community is its labor. Smith’s remarks about the invisible hand suggest that one can do more damage by trying to manipulate the system than by trusting it to work. This is the moral power of unintended consequences, as TMS’s account of the invisible hand makes clear as well.
What Smith relies upon here is not “moral luck” as Bernard Williams will later call it, but, rather, that nature is logical because it operates on principles, and, therefore, certain outcomes can be predicted. Smith recognizes that human beings and their interactions are part of nature and not to be understood separately from it. As in The Theory of Moral Sentiments, social and political behavior follows a natural logic. Now Smith makes the same claim for economic acts. Human society is as natural as the people in it, and, as such, Smith rejects the notion of a social contract in both of his books. There was never a time that humanity lived outside of society, and political development is the product of evolution (not his term) rather than a radical shift in organization. The state of nature is society for Smith and the Scots, and, therefore, the rules that govern the system necessitate certain outcomes.
b. History and Labor
Smith’s account of history describes human civilization as moving through four different stages, time periods that contain nations of hunters, nations of shepherds, agricultural nations, and, finally commercial societies (WN V.i.a, see, also, LJ(A) i.27; see also LJ(B) 25, 27, 149, 233). This is progress, Smith insists, and each form of society is superior to the previous one. It is also natural. This is how the system is designed to operate; history has a logic to it. Obviously, this account, in fact all of The Wealth of Nations, was very influential for Karl Marx. It marks the important beginning of what would be called social science—Smith’s successor to the Chair of Moral Philosophy, Adam Ferguson, is often identified as the founder of modern sociology—and is representative of the project the Scottish Enlightenment thinkers referred to as “the science of man.”
Smith’s discussion of history illustrates two other important points. First, he argues that the primary economic tension, and, as a result, the primary economic engine, in any given society can be found in the interaction between “the inhabitants of the town and those of the country” (WN III.i.1). According to Smith, agricultural lands supply the means of sustenance for any given society and urban populations provide the means of manufacture. Urban areas refine and advance the means of production and return some of its produce to rural people. In each of the stages, the town and country have a different relationship with each other, but they always interact.
Here, Smith is indebted to the physiocrats, French economists who believed that agricultural labor was the primary measure of national wealth. Smith accepted their notion that productive labor was a component of the wealth of nations but rejected their notion that only agricultural labor should be counted as value. He argues, instead, that if one group had to be regarded as more important, it would be the country since it provides food for the masses, but that it would be a mistake to regard one’s gain as the other’s loss or that their relationship is essentially hierarchical: “the gains of both are mutual and reciprocal, and the division of labour is in this, as in all other cases, advantageous to all the different persons employed in the various occupations into which it is subdivided” (WN III.i.1).
Again, there are philosophical issues here. First, is what one is to regard as labor; second is what counts towards economic value. Additionally, Smith is showing how the division of labor works on a large scale; it is not just for pin factories. Rather, different populations can be dedicated to different tasks for everyone’s benefit. (This might be an anticipation of David Ricardo’s notion of “comparative advantage.”) A commercial system is an integrated one and the invisible hand ensures that what benefits one group can also benefit another. Again, the butcher, brewer, and baker gain their livelihood by manufacturing the lunch of their customers.
Returning to Smith’s account of history, Smith also argues that historical moments and their economic arrangements help determine the form of government. As the economic stage changes, so does the form of government. Economics and politics are intertwined, Smith observes, and a feudal system could not have a republican government as is found in commercial societies. What Smith does here, again, is anticipate Marx’s dialectical materialism, showing how history influences economic and political options, but, of course, he does not take it nearly as far as the German does close to a century later.
Given the diversity of human experience—WN‘s stage theory of history helps account for difference—Smith is motivated to seek unifying standards that can help translate economic value between circumstances. Two examples are his discussions of price and his paradox of value. Within these discussions, Smith seeks an adequate measure of “worth” for goods and services. Consumers look at prices to gauge value, but there are good and bad amounts; which is which is not always transparent. Some items are marked too expensive for their actual value and some are a bargain. In developing a system to account for this interaction, Smith offers a range of different types of prices, but the two most important are natural price—the price that covers all the necessary costs of manufacture—and the market price, what a commodity actually goes for on the market. When the market and the natural prices are identical, the market is functioning well: “the natural price, therefore, is, as it were, the central price to which the prices of all commodities are continually gravitating” (WN I.vii.15).
Here, the term “gravitating” indicates, yet again, that there are principles that guide the economic system, and a properly functioning marketplace—one in which individuals are in “perfect liberty”—will have the natural and market prices coincide (WN i.vii.30). (Smith defines perfect liberty as a condition under which a person “may change his trade as often as he pleases” (WN I.vii.6)). Whether this is a normative value, whether for Smith the natural price is better than other prices, and whether the market price of a commodity should be in alignment with the natural price, is a matter of debate.
Following the question of worth, Smith poses the paradox of value. He explains: “Nothing is more useful than water: but it will purchase scarce any thing; scarce anything can be had in exchange for it. A diamond, on the contrary, has scarce any value in use; but a very great quantity of other goods may frequently be had in exchange for it” (WN I.iv.13). Smith’s question is straightforward: why is water so much cheaper than diamonds when it is so much more important for everyday life?
Obviously, we are tempted to argue that scarcity plays a role in the solution to this paradox; water is more valuable than diamonds to a person dying of thirst. For Smith, however, value, here, is general utility and it seems problematic to Smith that the more useful commodity has the lower market price. His solution, then, is to distinguish between two types of value, “value in use” and “value in exchange”—the former is the commodity’s utility and the latter is what it can be exchanged for in the market. Dividing the two analytically allows consumers to evaluate the goods both in terms of scarcity and in terms of usefulness. However, Smith is also searching for a normative or objective core in a fluctuating and contextual system, as with the role of impartiality in his moral system. Scarcity would not solve this problem because that, too, is fluctuating; usefulness is largely subjective and depends on an individual’s priorities and circumstance. Smith seeks a more universal criterion and looks towards labor to anchor his notion of value: “labour,” he writes, “is the real measure of the exchangeable value of all commodities” (WN I.v).
What Smith means by this is unclear and a matter of controversy. What seems likely, though, is that one person’s labor in any given society is not significantly different from another person’s. Human capabilities do not change radically from one time period or location to another, and their labor, therefore, can be compared: “the difference of natural talents in different men is, in reality, much less than we are aware of.” He elaborates:
Labour, therefore, it appears evidently, is the only universal, as well as the only accurate measure of value, or the only standard by which we can compare the values of different commodities at all times and at all places. We cannot estimate, it is allowed, the real value of different commodities from century to century by the quantities of silver which were given for them. We cannot estimate it from year to year by the quantities of corn. By the quantities of labour we can, with the greatest accuracy, estimate it both from century to century and from year to year. From century to century, corn is a better measure than silver, because, from century to century, equal quantities of corn will command the same quantity of labour more nearly than equal quantities of silver. From year to year, on the contrary, silver is a better measure than corn, because equal quantities of it will more nearly command the same quantity of labour. (WN I.v.17)
In other words, for example, a lone person can only lift so much wheat at one go, and while some people are stronger than others, the differences between them don’t make that much difference. Therefore, Smith seems to believe, the value of any object can be universally measured by the amount of labor that any person in any society might have to exert in order to acquire that object. While this is not necessarily a satisfying standard to all—many economists argue that the labor theory of value has been surpassed—it does, again, root Smith’s objectivity in impartiality. The “any person” quality of the impartial spectator is analogous to the “any laborer” standard Smith seems to use as a value measure.
Ultimately, according to Smith, a properly functioning market is one in which all these conditions—price, value, progress, efficiency, specialization, and universal opulence (wealth)—all work together to provide economic agents with a means to exchange accurately and freely as their self-interest motivates them. None of these conditions can be met if the government does not act appropriately, or if it oversteps its justified boundaries.
c. Political Economy
The Wealth of Nations is a work of political economy. It is concerned with much more than the mechanisms of exchange. It is also concerned with the ideal form of government for commercial advancement and the pursuit of self-interest. This is where Smith’s reputation as a laissez faire theorist comes in. He is arguing for a system, as he calls it, of “natural liberty,” one in which the market largely governs itself as is free from excessive state intervention (recall Smith’s use of the invisible hand in TMS). As he explains, there are only three proper roles for the sovereign: to protect a society from invasion by outside forces, to enforce justice and protect citizens from one another, and “thirdly, the duty of erecting and maintaining certain publick works and certain publick institutions, which it can never be for the interest of any individual, or small number of individuals, to erect and maintain; because the profit could never repay the expence to any individual or small number of individuals, though it may frequently do much more than repay it to a great society” (WN IV.ix).
Each of the responsibilities of the sovereign contains its own controversies. Regarding the first, protecting society, Smith debated with others as to whether a citizen militia or a standing army was better suited for the job, rooting his discussion, as usual, in a detailed history of the military in different stages of society (WN V.1.a). Given the nature of specialization, it should not be surprising that Smith favored the army (WN V.1.a.28). The nature of justice—the second role of the sovereign—is also complicated, and Smith never fully articulated his theory of what justice is and how it ought to be maintained, although, as we have seen, he was liberal in his assumptions of the rights of individuals against the imposition of government on matters of conscience and debate. In his chapter on “the expence of justice” (WN V.i.b), he discusses the nature of human subordination and why human beings like to impose themselves on one another. However, it is the third role of the sovereign—the maintenance of works that are too expensive for individuals to erect and maintain, or what are called “natural monopolies”—that is the most controversial.
It is this last book—ostensibly about the expenditures of government—that shows most clearly what Smith had in mind politically; the government plays a much stronger role in society than is often asserted. In particular, book five addresses the importance of universal education and social unity. Smith calls for religious tolerance and social regulation against extremism. For Smith, religion is an exceptionally fractious force in society because individuals tend to regard theological leaders as having more authority than political ones. This leads to fragmentation and social discord.
The discussion of “public goods” includes an elaborate discussion of toll roads, which, on the face of it, may seem to be a boring topic, but actually includes a fascinating account of why tolls should be based on the value of transported goods rather than on weight. This is Smith’s attempt to protect the poor—expensive goods are usually lighter than cheaper goods—think of diamonds compared to water—and if weight were the standard for tolls, justified, perhaps, by the wear and tear that the heavier goods cause, the poor would carry an undue share of transportation costs (WN V.i.d). However, the most intriguing sections of Book Five contain his two discussions of education (WN V.i.f–V.i.g). The first articulates the role of education for youth and the second describes the role of education for “people of all ages.”
The government has no small interest in maintaining schools to teach basic knowledge and skills to young people. While some of the expense is born by parents, much of this is to be paid for by society as a whole (WN V.i.f.54-55). The government also has a duty to educate adults, both to help counter superstition and to remedy the effects of the division of labor. Regarding the first, an educated population is more resistant to the claims of extremist religions. Smith also advocates public scrutiny of religious assertions in an attempt to moderate their practices. This, of course, echoes Smith’s moral theory in which the impartial spectator moderates the more extreme sentiments of moral agents. Finally, Smith insists that those who govern abandon associations with religious sects so that their loyalties do not conflict.
Regarding the second purpose of education for all ages, and again, anticipating Marx, Smith recognizes that the division of labor is destructive towards an individual’s intellect. Without education, “the torpor” (inactivity) of the worker’s mind:
renders him, not only incapable of relishing or bearing a part in any rational conversation, but of conceiving any generous, noble, or tender sentiment, and consequently of forming any just judgment concerning many even of the ordinary duties of private life. Of the great and extensive interests of his country, he is altogether incapable of judging; and unless very particular pains have been taken to render him otherwise, he is equally incapable of defending his country in war…. His dexterity at his own particular trade seems, in this manner, to be acquired at the expence of his intellectual, social, and martial virtues. But in every improved and civilized society this is the state into which the labouring poor, that is, the great body of the people, must necessarily fall, unless government takes some pains to prevent it. (WN V.i.f.50)
Education helps individuals overcome the monotony of day to day life. It helps them be better citizens, better soldiers, and more moral people; the intellect and the imagination are essential to moral judgment. No person can accurately sympathize if his or her mind is vacant and unskilled.
We see here that Smith is concerned about the poor throughout The Wealth of Nations. We also see the connections between his moral theory and his political economy. It is impossible to truly understand why Smith makes the political claims he does without connecting them to his moral claims, and vice versa. His call for universal wealth or opulence and his justification of limited government are themselves moral arguments as much as they are economic ones. This is why the Adam Smith Problem doesn’t make sense and why contemporary Smith scholars are so focused on showing the systematic elements of Smith’s philosophy. Without seeing how each of the parts fit together, one loses the power behind his reasoning—reasoning that inspired as much change as any other work in the history of the Western tradition. Of course, Smith has his detractors and his critics. He is making claims and building on assumptions that many challenge. But Smith has his defenders too, and, as history bears out, Smith is still an important voice in the investigation of how society ought to be organized and what principles govern human behavior, inquiry, and morality. The late twentieth century revival in Smith’s studies underscores that Smith’s philosophy may be as important now as it ever was.
4. References and Further Reading
All references are to The Glasgow Edition of the Correspondence and Works of Adam Smith, the definitive edition of his works. Online versions of much of these can be found at The Library of Economics and Liberty.
a. Work by Smith
- [TMS] Theory of Moral Sentiments. Ed. A.L. Macfie and D.D. Raphael. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
- First published in 1759; subsequent editions in 1761 (significantly revised), 1767, 1774, 1781, and 1790 (significantly revised with entirely new section).
- [WN] An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations. 2 vols. Ed. R.H. Campbell and A.S. Skinner. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1976.
- First published in 1776; subsequent editions in 1778, 1784 (significantly revised), 1786, 1789.
- [LJ] Lectures on Jurisprudence. Ed. R.L. Meek and D.D. Raphael. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
- Contains two sets of lectures, LJ(A), dated 1762–3 and LJ(B) dated 1766.
- [LRBL] The Lectures on Rhetoric and Belles Lettres. Ed. J.C. Bryce. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1985.
- Edition also contains the fragment: “Considerations Concerning the First Formation of Languages” in LRBL. Lecture dates, 1762–1763.
- [EPS] Essays on Philosophical Subjects. Ed. W.P.D. Wightman and J.C. Bryce. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
- Contains the essays and fragments: “The Principles Which Lead and Direct Philosophical Enquires Illustrated by the History of Astronomy,” “The Principles Which Lead and Direct Philosophical Enquires Illustrated by the History of Ancient Physics,” “ThePrinciples which lead and direct Philosophical Enquiries Illustrated by the History of the Ancient Logics and Metaphysics,” “Of the External Senses,” “Of the Nature of that Imitation which takes place in what are called The Imitative Arts,” “Of the Affinity between Music, Dancing, and Poetry,” “Of the Affinity between certain English and Italian Verses,” Contributions to the Edinburgh Review of 1755-56, Review of Johnson’s Dictionary, A Letter to the Authors of the Edinburgh Review, Preface and Dedication to William Hamilton’s Poems on Several Occasions 261 and Dugald Stewart’s “Account of the Life and Writings of Adam Smith, LL.D.” First published in 1795.
- [Corr.] Correspondence of Adam Smith. Ed. E.C. Mossner and I.S. Ross. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1987.
b. Companion Volumes to the Glasgow Edition
- Index to the Works of Adam Smith. Ed K. Haakonssen and A.S. Skinner. Indianapolis,: Liberty Press, 2002.
- Essays on Adam Smith. Edited by A.S. Skinner and Thomas Wilson. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1976.
- Life of Adam Smith. I.S. Ross. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.
c. Introductions and Works for a General Audience
- Berry, Christopher J. The Social Theory of the Scottish Enlightenment. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1997.
- Fleischacker, Samuel. On Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
- Haakonssen, K. (ed.) The Cambridge Companion to Adam Smith. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
- Muller, Jerry Z. Adam Smith in His Time and Ours. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1993.
- Otteson, James R. Adam Smith: Selected Philosophical Writings (Library of Scottish Philosophy). Exeter: Imprint Academic, 2004.
- Weinstein, Jack Russell. On Adam Smith. Belmont: Wadsworth, 2001.
- Raphael, D.D. Adam Smith (Past Masters). Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
d. Recommended Books for Specialists
Any issue of the journal The Adam Smith Review will be of interest to Smith’s readers. Volume 2 (2007) has a special symposium on Smith’s notion of rational choice (economic deliberation), and Volume 3 (2008) will have a special symposium on Smith and education. Both may deserve special attention.
- Campbell, T.D. Adam Smith’s Science of Morals. New Jersey: Rowman and Littlefield, 1971.
- Cropsey, Joseph. Polity and Economy: An Interpretation of the Principles of Adam Smith (With Further Thoughts on the Principles of Adam Smith) (Revised Edition). Chicago: St. Augustine’s Press, 2001.
- Evensky, J. Adam Smith’s Moral Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
- Force, Pierre. Self-interest before Adam Smith. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
- Griswold, Charles L. Jr. Adam Smith and the Virtues of Enlightenment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
- Haakonssen, Knud (ed.). Adam Smith (The International Library of Critical Essays in the History of Philosophy. Aldershot: Ashgate/Dartmouth Publishing, 1998.
- Haakonssen, Knud. The Science of A Legislator. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.
- Montes, Leonidas. Adam Smith in Context. New York: Palgrave MacMillan, 2004.
- Otteson, James. Adam Smith’s Marketplace of Life. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
- Raphael, D.D. The Impartial Spectator. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007.
- Scott, William Robert. Adam Smith as Student and Professor. New York: Augusts M. Kelley, 1965.
- Teichgraeber, Richard. Free Trade and Moral Philosophy: Rethinking the Sources of Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations. Durham, Duke University Press, 1986.
- Weinstein, Jack Russell. Adam Smith’s Pluralism: Rationality Education and the Moral Sentiments. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013.
Author Information
Jack Russell Weinstein
Email: jack.weinstein@und.edu
University of North Dakota
U. S. A.