Charles Sanders Peirce: Pragmatism

Pragmatism is a principle of inquiry and an account of meaning first proposed by C. S. Peirce in the 1870s. The crux of Peirce’s pragmatism is that for any statement to be meaningful, it must have practical bearings. Peirce saw the pragmatic account of meaning as a method for clearing up metaphysics and aiding scientific inquiry. This has led many to take Peirce’s early statement of pragmatism as a forerunner of the verificationist account of meaning championed by logical positivists. The early pragmatism of C.S. Peirce developed through the work of James and Dewey in the U. S. A, and F. C. S. Schiller in Great Britain. Peirce, however, remained unhappy with both his early formulations and the developments made by fellow pragmatists. This lead him, in later life, to refine his own earlier account and rename it “pragmaticism” in order to distinguish it from other more “nominalistic” versions.

The most widely known feature of Peirce’s philosophy is his account of pragmatism. Peirce made his first published attempts at formulating pragmatism in the 1870s, and the maxim he developed there is often regarded as a prototype of the verification principle proposed by logical positivists in the early twentieth century. This early body of work on pragmatism influenced William James who, some twenty years later, publicly declared for the doctrine, named Peirce as its originator, and made the theory common philosophical knowledge. Both Peirce and James took pragmatism to have its roots in older work than Peirce’s late nineteenth century theory. Peirce in particular saw traces of the theory in the work of Kant.

Introduction
Peirce’s Early Pragmatism
1. The Purpose of the Maxim
2. The Maxim and “Hardness”
Peirce’s Later Pragmatism
The Pragmatic Maxim and the Verification Principle
General Problems with The Maxim
Peirce and James: Pragmatism and Pragmaticism
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

Peirce returned repeatedly to his early formulations and especially in his later life and worked and re-worked his pragmatic theories, particularly in reaction to the work of William James. Clearly, then, there are two strands to Peirce’s pragmatism: his early statements of the 1870’s and his later work from around the turn of the twentieth century.

2. Peirce’s Early Pragmatism

The earliest clear statement of Peirce’s pragmatism comes from his 1878 paper “How To Make Our Ideas Clear.” In this paper, Peirce introduces a maxim, or principle, which allows us to achieve the highest grade of clarity about the concepts we use. Peirce introduces this principle, which we shall discuss in detail below as the third grade of clarity, as a development of the rationalist notion of “clear and distinct ideas.” Combining his pragmatic maxim with notions of clarity from Descartes and Leibniz, Peirce identifies three grades of clarity or understanding.

The first grade of clarity about a concept is to have an unreflective grasp of it in everyday experience. For instance, my inclination to keep some part of my body in stable contact with a supported horizontal surface at all times suggests that I have an underlying grasp of gravity. The second grade of clarity is to have, or be capable of providing, a definition of the concept. This definition should also be abstracted from any particular experience, i.e., it should be general. So, my ability to provide a definition of gravity (as, say, a force which attracts objects to a point, like the center of the earth) represents a grade of clarity or understanding over and above my unreflective use of that concept in walking, remaining upright, etc.

For Peirce, these two grades of clarity are only part way to a full understanding of a concept; there is a richer level of clarity. It is at this point that he introduces his own third grade of clarity. Peirce says:

Consider what effects, which might conceivably have practical bearings, we conceive the object of our conception to have. Then the whole of our conception of those effects is the whole of our conception of the object. (Peirce 1878/1992, p. 132)

On this account, then, to have a full understanding of some concept we must not only be familiar with it in day to day encounters, and be able to offer a definition of it, we must also know what effects to expect from holding that concept to be true.

For instance, a full understanding of the concept of “vinegar” comes from possessing all three grades of clarity about it. If I am able to identify vinegar and use the concept appropriately in my everyday experiences, I display the first grade of clarity about this concept. My ability to define “vinegar” as a diluted form of acetic acid, which is sharp to the taste, displays the second grade of clarity. Finally, from the use of “vinegar” in definitional propositions like “vinegar is diluted acetic acid” and “vinegar is sharp to taste,” I can derive a list of conditional propositions which indicate what to expect from actions upon, and interactions with, this concept. So, for instance, “vinegar is acetic acid” would lead me to form the expectation that “If vinegar is acetic acid, then if I dip litmus paper into it, it will turn red.” Having a list of conditional propositions like this, which express the differences this concept can make to expected experiences, allows me to achieve the highest grade of clarity about that concept. This third and final grade of clarity is the earliest statement of what we now know as the pragmatic maxim; it is the crux of Peirce’s early theory of pragmatism.

It should be clear that Peirce’s pragmatic maxim accords with his scientific inclinations. For Peirce, understanding the practical upshot of our concepts means exploring and experimenting upon the conditional hypotheses that we formulate with them. This not only reflects his broader notion of philosophy as a practical laboratory science, but also informs our conception of Peirce’s pragmatic maxim, as it is expressed in “How to Make Our Ideas Clear,” as an account of meaning. The meaning of a concept is expressed by the list of conditional hypotheses that it generates. Interestingly, this seems to generate an account of meaning with two main elements: use and understanding.

The use element of the pragmatic maxim as an account of meaning is apparent from the meanings of the conditionals generated with the maxim. For instance, the meaning expressed by conditional statements about “vinegar” are not strictly about that concept considered in isolation. Rather, they provide the meaning for propositions containing the concept, such as “vinegar is diluted acetic acid,” or “vinegar is sharp to taste.” These conditional statements concern the practical experimental upshot of these propositions, rather than of the concept abstracted from them. This seems to generate meaning for concepts as they are used in sentences and propositions. It also makes the account of meaning an account of meaning for whole sentences, etc.

The second element of the pragmatic maxim as an account of meaning is understanding. We can see that it is the possibility of our understanding the outcome of taking a hypothesis to be true (in the form of conditional statements) that expresses the meaning of a concept. Since a meaningful statement is one for which we can derive practical and experiential consequences, our understanding, or grasp of those consequences, is our understanding or grasp of the meaning.

a. The Purpose of the Maxim

The pragmatic maxim, then, is the means for achieving the third grade of clarity in our understanding of a concept. The list of conditional statements that we generate for a concept lists the effects and practical outcome that we can expect from this concept if the statements containing it turn out to be true. However, Peirce develops the pragmatic maxim and the clarifying method that it represents with some very particular purpose in mind.

As we have already suggested, Peirce’s main use for the pragmatic maxim is as an account of meaning. Quite simply, this enables Peirce to clearly identify useful and meaningful sentences. For instance, if we do not conceive the object of our conceptions to have any practical bearings, then it clearly does not have meaning. This ability to identify meaningful and meaningless statements allows Peirce to make use of the maxim in two ways.

The first use for the pragmatic maxim is the role it plays in Peirce’s account of Inquiry and the accompanying notions of truth and reality. For Peirce, the attainment of truth comes from taking investigation and inquiry as far as it can go. The beliefs we find ourselves accepting at the limit of inquiry represent the truth. What is more, for Peirce, the only way to take inquiry to its limit is through the adoption of a scientific method. However, some criterion of choice is required in order to find which statements/hypotheses etc. are worth investigating. For Peirce, the pragmatic maxim is just such a criterion. Put in its simplest terms, the pragmatic maxim allows us to see what difference the truth of certain concepts would make to our lives. This knowledge further allows us to decide where the best focus for our scientific investigations and belief-settling inquiry lies. If, of two concepts, our investigating the truth of one over the other is likely to have a greater impact upon our reaching a settled state of opinion, then that is the one we should investigate. The only way we are able to see which of the two concepts is likely to have a greater impact is to use the pragmatic maxim and the final grade of clarity or understanding that it affords us.

Peirce’s second use for the pragmatic maxim is to identify those propositions of metaphysics that turn out to be meaningless. For Peirce, the pragmatic maxim enables us to steer clear of metaphysical distractions. The bulk of “ontological metaphysics,” by which Peirce means metaphysics conducted by a priori reasoning alone, has no practical bearing and so will make no contribution to the final fixed state of beliefs. This renders them meaningless. It is this use of the pragmatic maxim as a filter against empty metaphysical statements that ultimately leads to a comparison between Peirce’s maxim and the verification principles of the logical positivists. We will look at the similarities between Peirce’s pragmatic maxim and verificationist accounts of meaning in due course, but for the time being, it is worth noting that both Peirce and the logical positivists see the possibility of ruling out much of metaphysics on the grounds that it has no experiential consequences.

b. The Maxim and “Hardness”

Very quickly, Peirce began to feel that there were difficulties with this early account of the pragmatic maxim. In “How to Make Our Ideas Clear,” Peirce used the concept of “hardness” to illustrate the usefulness of his pragmatic maxim. This lead him to the conditional statement that “If something is hard, it will not be scratched by many other things” as an example, amongst many, of the practical upshot of taking our concept of “hardness” to be true. However, Peirce goes on to raise the question: what do we say about the hardness of a diamond, destroyed before we are able to test it for that quality?

In response, Peirce says that it would not be false to say that the diamond in question was soft. He states that, “there is absolutely no difference between a hard and a soft thing so long as they are not brought to the test” (Peirce 1992-94, vol. II, p. 131). Peirce’s unwillingness to say that the diamond is hard is, in part, a consequence of the way he ties his pragmatic maxim to his account of inquiry. Since any belief that we form about this particular diamond will fail to meet with recalcitrant evidence (there is no longer a diamond to conduct tests upon and so no possibility of confirming or dis-confirming the statement about the hardness of the diamond) we can form any belief we like about its hardness; it is largely a matter of “verbal disagreement.”

Peirce was to return to this issue in his second major period of work on pragmatism with some regret about this counterintuitive feature of his early pragmatic maxim.

3. Peirce’s Later Pragmatism

After his statement of pragmatism in the 1870’s, Peirce did not fully return to it for around twenty years. Peirce had toyed, throughout the 1890’s, with his ideas on the pragmatic maxim but it was not until James’ California Union Address in 1898 that he felt spurred on to a second major effort at formulating his pragmatism. James publicly named the doctrine of pragmatism and identified Peirce as its founder. Famously, James misremembered seeing the term “pragmatism” in Peirce’s “How to Make Our Ideas Clear”. James was, however, correct in identifying this paper as the first source of pragmatism in Peirce’s work. It was from here that James and other pragmatists, like Schiller, took Peirce’s pragmatic maxim and moved it in new directions.

By the turn of the twentieth century, then, Peirce’s need to re-engage with pragmatism was paramount. First of all, it would provide him an opportunity to use James’ acknowledgment of his work to gain a toehold in the philosophical and academic arena. Also, on a less personal level, Peirce did not wholly approve of the directions in which James and Schiller were taking pragmatism. This led him to rename his own brand of pragmatism “pragmaticism,” claiming that this title was “ugly enough to be safe from kidnappers.” Throughout the first decade of the 1900’s, then, Peirce attempted, in Harvard lectures and a series of articles for The Monist, to develop the theory he had first detailed in the 1870’s.

The most notable difference between Peirce’s later accounts of pragmatism and his earlier approach is his attitude to the question of whether the destroyed diamond was hard. This had a profound effect on the way he formulated the conditional propositions that constitute the pragmatic meaning of a concept, as we shall see. Recall that in his account of the 1870’s, Peirce maintained that since the diamond was not tested, it made no difference if we said that it was hard or soft. In his later formulations of pragmatism, Peirce states that we can definitely know that the destroyed diamond was hard.

The underlying cause of this change of heart is Peirce’s adoption of a more sophisticated approach to the reality of modal notions like necessity and possibility. In the 1870’s, Peirce’s account of possibility and necessity are based on the epistemological facts about believers in relation to some statement containing modal terms. For instance, to say that something is necessary is just to say that we know it must be the case. And to say that something is possible is just to say that we do not know it not to be the case. This reduces the reality of modal notions to facts about speakers and the words they use. In his later work, Peirce took this account and his early attitude to the diamond example to be crass “nominalism” on his part: he had failed to be a realist about possibilities, or “would-bes,” as he called them.

Peirce’s use of “nominalism” requires some explanation. Nominalism is more normally associated with the medieval discussion on the existence of universals. The nominalist position in this debate sought to explain universals in terms of properties of the words or names used (hence “nominalism” from nominalis or belonging to the name) rather than as separately existing forms. Peirce, however, uses “nominalism” to refer to any theory that does not take the real separate existence of laws, generalities, possibilities etc. seriously. His earlier explanation of possibilities or “would-bes” in terms of properties of knowers, then, counts, for him, as “nominalism.” As such, Peirce’s adoption of a realist position on possibility, that is a commitment to possibilities or “would-bes” as independently real, around 1896/97 provided the foundation for a significant change in his pragmatism.

In his later account of pragmatism, Peirce takes subjunctive conditionals, rather than indicative conditionals, to form the list of conditional propositions that constitute the meaning of our concepts. For instance, on the 1878 account, conditional statements generated for propositions like “vinegar is diluted acetic acid” would include, “If litmus paper is dipped into it then it will turn that paper red.” This is an indicative conditional, expressing what will happen. On this account, it does not make sense to say that a diamond will resist abrasive substances if the diamond is destroyed before testing can take place. Peirce’s later formulation, though, offers us conditionals like, “If we were to dip litmus paper into it then that paper would turn red,” for propositions like “vinegar is diluted acetic acid.” This subjunctive formulation, with regards the diamond example, sees statements like “this diamond is hard” generating a list of subjunctive conditionals like “If we were to rub this diamond with most materials then it would not be scratched.” Conditionals like this hold whether we test the diamond for hardness or not. Consequently, Peirce’s later pragmatism formulates the pragmatic meaning of concepts (or statements) in terms of subjunctive conditionals; his earlier account uses indicative conditionals.

A further development in Peirce’s later expression of pragmatism is the extent to which he places the pragmatic maxim within his wider philosophical account. In the 1870’s, Peirce’s pragmatic maxim is a part of his account of inquiry, suggesting and clarifying concepts worthy of exploration. By the turn of the twentieth century, Peirce’s architectonic vision of philosophy was in full construction and the concept of inquiry was part of a much broader structure. Consequently, Peirce sought to find an alternative expression of his pragmatic maxim more sensitive to the position of inquiry within his architectonic schema. Inquiry was now firmly realized as a part of logic (broadly conceived as semiotic), and more importantly, as one of the normative sciences in Peirce’s architectonic classification. Further, logic was to form the basis of a scientific metaphysics. Peirce’s later pragmatism, then, needed to move away from the more “nominalistic” emphasis of his earlier account, which made meaning a matter of actual descriptive accounts of practical experiences and effects. The strongly descriptive formulation of pragmatic meaning from the 1870’s ran counter to Peirce’s later prescriptivist view of inquiry as the self-controlled, scientific pursuit of concrete reasonableness. This further explains Peirce’s adoption of subjunctive conditionals: they are more sensitive to the prescriptivism of inquiry as a part of the architectonic.

Peirce also needed an account of pragmatism more sympathetic to his metaphysics. By the turn of the century, Peirce had come to realize fully the role of metaphysics in his system, and rather than dispose of it as empty theorizing, Peirce felt the need to reconstruct it as a meaningful science. His early account of the pragmatic maxim was strongly empirical and in “How To Make Our Ideas Clear,” Peirce defines “practical effects” as “sensible effects” (Peirce 1992-94, vol. I, p. 132), or “effects […] upon our senses” (ibid., p. 131). This tying of the meaningful to the observable needs careful statement if it is not to rule out all but the immediate experiences of our senses. Peirce’s earliest characterization runs close to this. However, his later accounts attempt to broaden the notion of experience beyond the directly observable in an attempt to avoid rendering all metaphysics empty.

Peirce draws a distinction between “real” and “ideal” experience. The former is what we would normally think of as experience through the senses. The later involves diagrammatic reasoning, employed by mathematicians for instance. For Peirce, “ideal” experience involves performing transformations and operations upon diagrams, and “experiencing,” or observing, the result. Algebraic equations and the transformations we perform upon them, for instance, count as diagrammatic or “ideal” experiences. Since “ideal” reasoning is, in many ways, just mathematical and deductive experience, we might take Peirce to be doing little more than pre-empting the logical positivist’s allowance of analytic statements as valid sentences; he simply draws the distinction between the empirically observable and the analytic in a different way. However, Peirce is doing more than this.

Peirce’s mature philosophy is infused with his realism about possibility and generality. Both are important for his scientific metaphysics. What he needs is some way of explaining our experience of these things. The ability to reason, deduce, and infer allows us to use laws and habits and identify possible outcomes and, at the same time, take them seriously as real generalities and possibilities. This has an interesting effect on Peirce’s later notion of the pragmatic maxim. By 1903 and the Harvard Lectures on Pragmatism, the notion of practical effects from the earlier formulation had developed. Peirce, now sensitive to his own modal realism and more sophisticated metaphysical requirements, took the pragmatic maxim to “allow any flight of imagination provided this imagination ultimately alights upon a possible practical effect” (Peirce 1992-94, vol. II, p. 235).

4. The Pragmatic Maxim and the Verification Principle

Peirce’s pragmatic maxim is often compared with the logical positivist’s verification principle of meaning. With a clearer grasp of the pragmatic maxim, particularly in its later, more mature incarnation, it is worth commenting upon this comparison.

There are, indeed, certain similarities between the pragmatic maxim and the verification principle. For instance, the verification principle takes a sentence to be meaningful if there exists an experience that confirms or disconfirms it. As such, it shares with the pragmatic maxim an experiential or practical criterion of meaning; for both, a proposition must have some observable effect in the world to be meaningful. Also of interest, is that both purposefully use their criterion of meaning (through experiential effects) to identify “meaningless” statements. For both, a hypothesis with no observable or practical effects is without meaning. What is more, both use this ability to identify meaningless statements to reassess the content of metaphysics and demarcate worthwhile philosophy from areas where no real contribution can be made. For instance, Peirce thinks that his pragmatic philosophy can make no real contribution to areas of practical ethics: Logical positivists either class ethics with metaphysics as disposable, or make it a matter of opinion.

However, once we are aware of how Peirce’s account of pragmatism began to develop, the similarities between the maxim and the verification principle begin to get a little strained. Furthermore, some of the marked differences between the verification principle and all of Peirce’s formulations of the maxim become more prominent. First, although both share a desire to reassess metaphysics, the verificationists wish to render it obsolete; this was never an objective for Peirce. For Peirce, the reassessment of metaphysics involves bestowing upon it a scientific respectability and, although this objective is clearer in his later work, he always intended to retain some form of metaphysical philosophy.

The other crucial difference between the pragmatic maxim and the verification principle is the notion of experience. For verificationists, a verifiable experience is a directly observable one, i.e. observable in terms of simple sensory experience. Peirce, on the other hand, particularly with his later formulations of the maxim, has a broader concept of experience. As we have seen, Peirce’s modal realism, or commitment to the reality of “would-bes” characterizes his later accounts. This marks a crucial difference between the two and logical positivist like Carnap would no doubt feel uncomfortable with Peirce’s claims here. Peirce would no doubt think that the logical positivists were too “nominalistic.” Clearly then, Peirce’s pragmatic maxim is not simply a forerunner to the verification principle.

5. General Problems with The Maxim

Although there are clear differences between the pragmatic maxim and the verification principle, they are similar enough for Peirce to face some of the same difficulties encountered by Logical Positivists. A general difficulty for the verification principle is how to formulate it in a way that ensures the right kind of sentences count as meaningful. Traditional criticisms of the verification principle include the thought that in some of its formulations, it is too austere. Sentences about the past, unobservable entities like quarks, etc. are meaningless since there are no directly observable experiences that can confirm them. Peirce felt that this austerity towards meaning was an upshot of his early formulations of the pragmatic maxim, ruling out all metaphysics, including the kind that he felt might be respectable enough to count as meaningful. This led to the more generous construal of experience in his later formulations.

However, whether or not Peirce’s later formulations in terms of “possible practical effects” allow too much to count as meaningful is open to debate. For instance, because the formulation of the maxim in terms of possible practical effects, rather than actual or realized effects, seems to shift the focus of the maxim to expectations rather than actions, the body of meaningful sentences arguably becomes too inclusive. If we can show that some hypothesis or statement has some possible practical effect, then the Christian expectation of the second coming of Christ, say, and the avoidance of sin that it results in, seems to count towards the pragmatic meaning of “God is real.” Although Peirce does actually attempt to argue for the existence of God along similar lines, suggesting that “God is real” has the possible practical effect of seeing man’s “self-controlled conduct” increase (Peirce 1992-94, vol. II, p. 446), it is not clear that this development of the maxim is entirely healthy. The use of the pragmatic maxim in Peirce’s later work appears to take on metaphysical baggage that had previously been disposed of, allowing what counts as meaningful to run out of control. It seems, then, that the pragmatic maxim, in all of its formulations, struggles to steer a course between the austerity of the early pragmatism, and the laxity of the later more metaphysically tolerant formulations.

One final peculiarity of the pragmatic maxim, in both its early and late formulations, is that all propositions ultimately become future referring. This is fine with most hypotheses like “diamonds are hard” or “vinegar is diluted acetic acid,” since it is their contribution, possible or otherwise, to future experience that matters. However, statements or hypotheses about the past, rather oddly, become focused on their future effects. So, the pragmatic meaning of “John F. Kennedy was assassinated” generates conditionals about our future investigations, checking history books, reading the Warren report, watching TV footage, and asking those who knew him, etc. This feels counterintuitive, since the statement in question, “John F. Kennedy was assassinated,” seems to be about what happened to J.F.K., rather than about our experiences in unearthing support for its truth.

Despite this rather counterintuitive generation of future referring conditionals for hypotheses about the past, it is not clear that it does a great deal of damage to Peirce’s pragmatism. Rather, it is just a quirk of the maxim’s expression of meaning in terms of action or expectations.

6. Peirce and James: Pragmatism and Pragmaticism

One truly interesting issue for Peirce’s pragmatism is the relationship it bears to the work of the pragmatic philosophers that followed him. Peirce’s pragmatism influenced William James, John Dewey, Josiah Royce and F.C.S Schiller to name but a few of his American and British contemporaries. However, the influence upon and contrast with the work of William James is perhaps the most interesting. This is because although Peirce’s maxim and his work in the 1870’s provide the foundation for many early pragmatists, it is James that popularized the pragmatist approach to philosophy and James’ pragmatism that looms large in our common philosophical understanding of the doctrine. Also, because of the role of James as popularizer, it is his development that prompted much of Peirce’s later reevaluation of his own theory. In order to see what is unique and interesting in Peirce’s pragmaticism, then, it is worth emphasizing some of the crucial differences between Peirce and James’ take on pragmatism.

The primary difference between Peirce and James is that the pragmatic maxim in Peirce’s work is a theory of meaning, but in the hands of James, it becomes a theory of truth. This, however, is due to more crucial differences between the two that mean James’ notion of pragmatism far outstretches a simple meaning criterion, and reflects his more fundamental thoughts about philosophy in general. This comes most prominently to the fore in their basic ideas about the place of pragmatism in philosophy as a whole.

Firstly, Peirce and James have different ideas about the philosophical uses to which a pragmatic method should be put. James is famously anti-intellectualist in his philosophy, distrusting the extent to which we can answer all the important human questions with a materialistic and scientific approach to understanding the universe and our place in it. Peirce, on the other hand, particularly in his later work, sees the whole of philosophy embedded within a scientific system and the pragmatic maxim centrally embedded in philosophy. The consequence is that James tends to see pragmatism, and his philosophy, as the stepping off point where materialist and purely intellectualist sciences fail to answer our questions about which beliefs are justifiable. Religious and moral questions require a separate criterion of justification, and this is where a pragmatic method determines what difference I take some such belief to have, and why it is reasonable to hold that belief.

For Peirce, philosophy in general, and the pragmatic maxim in particular, should never stray this far from scientific inquiry. The important philosophical questions, and those with which the pragmatic maxim are concerned, remain firmly within the realm of scientific and intellectualist inquiry. As far as Peirce is concerned, the questions to which James is inclined to apply a pragmatic method are largely beyond the realm of fruitful philosophical inquiry. For Peirce pragmatism is strictly within the realms of scientific sensibilities: for James, it begins at the point where our scientific explanations fall short.

These two different outlooks on philosophy and pragmatism underwrite two very different attitudes to the usefulness of pragmatism entirely. Peirce sees pragmatism as a logical principle. The maxim is a tool of analysis designed to make our concepts clear and logically precise. For James, pragmatism is a philosophical outlook. For him, pragmatism is an approach to philosophy that looks towards the consequences of belief, which looks at human action, and moves the whole enterprise of understanding them, away from scientifically founded philosophy. These two different attitudes result in some further interesting features of the two philosophies.

Firstly, James’ pragmatism, in many ways, looks like a total break with traditionalist concerns. For James, pragmatism makes a move away from the philosophies of Kant and Hegel, with their emphasis upon first principles, categories etc. Indeed, the neo-pragmatism of Richard Rorty takes James’ work to be the decisive shift from traditional philosophy to modern concerns. Of course, Peirce’s philosophy retains the architectonic approach with first principles and categories and looks traditionalist as a result. In many ways, it is these features of Peirce’s work that leaves Rorty unconvinced by Peirce’s status as a pragmatist philosopher.

In another respect though, it is James that looks to have remained within the traditionalist mold and Peirce’s pragmatism that looks progressive. James’ particular take on pragmatism looks towards the individual and the effects of belief upon some person or another. Peirce’s pragmatism on the other hand, looks towards experience in general and effects across persons. For Peirce, the establishment of habit across persons and communities is what is interesting about “practical upshots,” not individual action and reaction. The contrast between James’ individualist approach and Peirce’s communalism is interesting. Individualism is characteristic of much of traditional philosophy, particularly since Descartes, and in this respect, James retains much of the baggage of traditional philosophy. Peirce’s communalism, though, has a particular resonance with contemporary attitudes, particularly since the later Wittgenstein.

One final difference in the pragmatisms of Peirce and James, then, are their different attitudes to the reality of modal notions like possibility and necessity. James saw pragmatism as fundamentally “nominalistic.” As such, the reality of possibilities and so on is explained in James’ philosophy in a way similar to that of the early Peirce, i.e. subjective and epistemological. Peirce’s own mature take on modal notions, as we know, is to be a realist about “would-bes.” This makes his pragmatism focus less on actual occurrences and more on potential effects. It also has the further effect of making his pragmatism take the idea of laws and long run habit more seriously; the idea of natural law concerning the “hardness” of diamonds is, after all, part of his explanation of why the destroyed diamond can count as hard.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Peirce, C.S. 1931-58. The Collected Papers of Charles Sanders Peirce, eds. C. Hartshorne, P. Weiss (Vols. 1-6) and A. Burks (Vols. 7-8). (Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press).
- The first wide spread presentation of Peirce’s work both published and unpublished; its topical arrangement makes it misleading but it is still the first source for most people.
Peirce, C.S. 1982 —. The Writings of Charles S. Peirce: A Chronological Edition, eds. M. Fisch, C. Kloesel, E. Moore, N. Houser et al., (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press).
- The ongoing vision of the late Max Fisch and colleagues to produce an extensive presentation of Peirce’s views on a par with The Collected Papers, but without its idiosyncrasies. Currently published in eight volumes (of thirty) up to 1884, it is rapidly superseding its predecessor.
Peirce, C.S. 1992-94. The Essential Peirce, eds. N. Houser and C. Kloesel (Vol. 1) and the Peirce Edition Project (Vol. 2), (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press).
- A crucial two volume reader of the cornerstone works of Peirce’s writings. Equally important are the introductory commentaries by Nathan Houser.
Peirce, C.S. 1878/1992. “How To Make Our Ideas Clear.” In The Essential Peirce, Vol.1, eds. N. Houser and C. Kloesel. (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press), pp. 124-141.
- Peirce’s first statement of pragmatism and the source to which James refers as the seminary of his own pragmatism.
Peirce, C.S. 1903/1998. “Harvard Lectures on Pragmatism.” In The Essential Peirce, Vol.2., ed. The Peirce Edition Project. (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press), chs. 10-16.
- Often difficult later statement of Peirce’s pragmatism. It is here that Peirce tries to expound his own mature views on pragmatism as part of an architectonically embedded logic, dependent upon ethics and aesthetics.
Peirce, C.S. 1905/1998. “What Pragmatism Is.” In The Essential Peirce, Vol.2., ed. The Peirce Edition Project. (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press), pp. 331-345.
- One of Peirce’s late Monist articles on pragmatism where he publicly distinguishes his “pragmaticism” from the pragmatism of James. The rest of the Monist series, and other work on his “pragmaticism” are reproduced in The Essential Peirce, Vol.2 and are worth looking at.

b. Secondary Sources

Gruender, D. 1983. “Pragmatism, Science and Metaphysics.” In The Relevance of Charles Peirce, ed. Eugene Freeman. (La Salle, IL: Monist Library of Philosophy), pp. 271-291.
- Expands the often-made comparison between Peirce’s pragmatic maxim and the verification principle by comparing Peirce’s and Carnap’s accounts of meaning and science.
Hookway, C.J. 1997. “Logical Principles and Philosophical Attitudes: Peirce’s Response to James’ Pragmatism.” In The Cambridge Companion to William James, ed. Ruth Anna Putnam. (New York: Cambridge University Press), pp. 145-165.
- Interesting, useful and detailed comparison of the work of James and Peirce, emphasizing their different motivations in using pragmatism, with particular emphasis on Peirce’s own understanding of James’ work.
Hookway, C.J. 2000. “Avoiding Circularity and Proving Pragmatism.” In Truth, Rationality, and Pragmatism. (Oxford: Clarendon Press), pp. 285-303.
- A discussion that takes Peirce’s later concerns with the logical status of pragmatism further than we have done here. Hookway details Peirce’s late concern with attempting to “prove” his own pragmatic maxim by discussing the structure that such a proof should take.
Houser, N. 1998. “Introduction to The Essential Peirce Vol. 2.” In The Essential Peirce, Vol.2, ed. The Peirce Edition Project. (Bloomington IN: Indiana University Press), pp. xvii-xxxviii.
- Houser’s introduction and discussion of the papers included in The Essential Peirce Vol. 2, offers a detailed look at the development of Peirce later thoughts on pragmatism. Further, a discussion of Peirce’s efforts to a find a “proof” for his maxim provides useful insight into Peirce’s pragmatism.
Misak, C., 1991. Truth and the End of Inquiry. (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
- In chapter one of this book, Misak discusses the pragmatic maxim at length and investigates its different formulations from early to late, assessing their shortcomings. Of particular interest, is her insistence on the importance of pragmatism to Peirce’s account of truth.

Author Information

Albert Atkin
Email: pip99aka@sheffield.ac.uk
University of Sheffield
United Kingdom

Pascal’s Wager about God

Blaise Pascal (1623-1662) offers a pragmatic reason for believing in God: even under the assumption that God’s existence is unlikely, the potential benefits of believing are so vast as to make betting on theism rational. The super-dominance form of the argument conveys the basic Pascalian idea, the expectations argument refines it, and the dominating expectations argument gives a more sophisticated version still.

Critics in turn have raised a number of now-classic challenges. (i) According to intellectualism, deliberately choosing which beliefs to hold is practically impossible. Intellectualism, however, appears to be not only questionable but irrelevant. (ii) According to the many-gods objection, Pascal’s wager begs the question and hence is irrational. It assumes that if God exists then God must take a rather specific form, which few open-minded agnostics would accept. Pascalians reply by invoking the notion of a genuine option (which is not defined), by devising run-off decision theory (which is not justified), by claiming that Pascal was understandably unaware of other cultures (which is not true), and by appealing to generic theism (which does not solve the problem).

(iii) According to evidentialism, Pascalian reasoning is epistemically irresponsible and hence immoral. One development of this argument, suggesting that God is an evidentialist, amounts to a variant of the many-gods objection. Another development, suggesting that we should be evidentialists, hinges on the outcome of larger moral theory. (iv) According to various paradoxes, reference to infinite values is decision-theoretic non-sense.

A Reason for Believing in God
The Intellectualist Objection: Is Belief a Matter of Choice?
The Many-Gods Objection: Do Rival Religious Options Undermine Each Other?
The Evidentialist Objection: Is Prudential Reasoning Ethical?
The Paradox Objection: Is Decision Theory Coherent?
1. The Equi-utility Paradox
2. The St. Petersburg Paradox
References and Further Reading

1. A Reason for Believing in God

There are two kinds of argument for theism. Traditional, epistemic arguments hold that God exists; examples include arguments from cosmology, design, ontology, and experience. Modern, pragmatic arguments hold that, regardless of whether God exists, believing in God is good for us, or is the right thing to do; examples include William James’s will to believe and Blaise Pascal’s wager.

Pascal — French philosopher, scientist, mathematician and probability theorist (1623-1662) — argues that if we do not know whether God exists then we should play it safe rather than risk being sorry. The argument comes in three versions (Hacking 1972), all of them employing decision theory.

For those who are unfamiliar with decision theory, the idea can be illustrated by considering a lottery. Suppose there are 100 tickets at $1 each and a jackpot of $1000. Is it rational to play? If you total the earnings and the expenses for all the tickets ($1000 – $100), then divide by the number of tickets, you find that on average each ticket nets $9. In comparison, not playing involves zero expense and zero payoff. Since $9 is preferable to $0, it is rational to play. Alternately, suppose there are 1000 tickets costing $2 each, a grand prize of $1000, and a consolation prize of $500. Then the total earnings and expenses ($1500 – $2000), divided by the number of tickets, yields a net loss of fifty cents for the average ticket. In this case, unless you have some reason to believe that a given ticket is not average, playing the game is irrational.

To put the matter more generally: a given action (say, buying a ticket) is associated with a set of possible outcomes (say, winning the grand prize, winning the consolation prize, or losing); each outcome has a certain value or “utility” (the utility of winning might be the value of the prize minus the cost of the ticket); the “expectation” for each outcome is equal to its utility multiplied by the probability of its happening; the expectation for a given action is the sum of the expectations for each possible associated outcome. The course of action having the maximum expectation is the rational one to follow.

a. The Super-Dominance Argument

Pascal begins with a two-by-two matrix: either God exists or does not, and either you believe or do not.

–Table I–	God exists	God does not exist
You believe in God	(a) infinite reward	(c) 250 utiles
You do not believe in God	(b) infinite punishment	(d) 200 utiles

If God exists then theists will enjoy eternal bliss (cell a), while atheists will suffer eternal damnation (cell b). If God does not exist then theists will enjoy finite happiness before they die (say 250 units worth), and atheists will enjoy finite happiness too, though not so much because they will experience angst rather than the comforts of religion. Regardless of whether God exists, then, theists have it better than atheists; hence belief in God is the most rational belief to have.

b. The Expectations Argument

What if the atheist is a happy hedonist, or if the theist is a miserable puritan? In that case the value of cell (d) is greater than that of (c), and the dominance argument no longer works. However, if there is a 50-50 chance that God exists then we can calculate the expectations as follows:

–Table II–	God exists	God does not exist
You believe in God	+infinity	something finite
You do not believe in God	-infinity	something finite

Using the table, the expectation for believing in God = (positive infinity x ½) + (a finite value x ½) = positive infinity; and the expectation for not believing = (negative infinity x ½) + (a finite value x ½) = negative infinity. Hence it is rational to believe in God.

c. The Dominating Expectations Argument

It’s unlikely that the probability of God’s existing is exactly one-half, but this does not matter. Due to the infinite value in cell (a), if God’s existence has any finite probability then the expectation for believing in God will be infinite. Furthermore, this infinity will swamp the values in cells (b), (c), and (d), so long as (c) is not infinitely negative and neither (b) nor (d) is infinitely positive.

2. The Intellectualist Objection: Is Belief a Matter of Choice?

According to doxastic voluntarism, believing and disbelieving are choices that are up to us to make. Intellectualists deny this; they say it is impossible to adopt a belief simply because we decide to. If I offered to pay you $1000 for believing the sky is green, for instance, could you sincerely adopt this belief simply by wishing to? Evidently not. Therefore, some say, Pascal’s wager does not give legitimate grounds for believing in God.

But although we cannot adopt a belief simply by deciding to, the same is true for other actions. For instance, we cannot go to school simply by deciding to; rather, we have to wake up by a certain time (which may mean first developing a certain kind of habit), we must get dressed, we must put one foot in front of another, and so forth. Then if we are lucky we will end up at our destination, though this is far from guaranteed. So it goes for any other endeavor in life: one chooses to become a doctor, or to marry by age 30, or to live in the tropics — the attainment of such goals can be facilitated, though not purely willed, by appropriate micro-steps that are more nearly under voluntary control. Indeed, even twitching your little finger is not entirely a matter of volition, as its success depends on a functioning neural system running from your brain, through your spine, and down your arm. Your minutest action is a joint product of internal volition and external contingencies. The same applies to theistic belief: although you cannot simply decide to be a theist, you can choose to read one-sided literature, you can choose to join a highly religious community, you can try to induce mystical experiences by ingesting psychedelic drugs like LSD, and you can choose to chant and pray. No mere exercise of will can guarantee that you will end up believing in God, but neither can any exercise of will guarantee that you succeed in doing anything else you decide to do. If there is a difference between our ability to voluntarily believe something and our ability to voluntarily wiggle our toe, it is a difference in degree of likely success, and not a difference in logical kind.

Yet a difference in degree may be significant, and it is worth noting that theists and atheists may disagree on the power of prayer to change one’s beliefs. Theists generally think that prayer tends to bring one into contact with God, in which case one is likely to notice, recognize, and believe in God’s existence. Atheists, on the other hand, have no particular reason to think that mere praying should notably effect conversion. An agnostic would do well then to try; for it would be precisely in the case where success matters that trying is likely to be most efficacious.

Indeed, it might not matter whether we can choose to have the beliefs we have. If Tables I or II be right then the fact would remain that it is pragmatically better to believe in God than not, insofar as theists, taken across all possible worlds, are on average better off than atheists. It does not matter whether theism results from personal will-power, God’s grace, or cosmic luck — regardless, being better off is being better off. Thus, Pascal’s wager need not succeed as a tool of persuasion for it to serve as a tool of assessment (Mougin & Sober 1994).

3. The Many-Gods Objection: Do Rival Religious Options Undermine Each Other?

Pascal’s compatriot Denis Diderot replied to the wager that an ayatollah or “imam could just as well reason the same way.” His point is that decision theory cannot decide among the various religions practiced in the world; it gives no warrant for believing in Pascal’s Catholicism, or even in a generic Judeo-Christianity. The reason is that Tables I and II beg the question in favor of a certain kind of theism; a more complete matrix must consider at least the following possibilities.

–Table III–	Yahweh exists	Allah exists
You worship Yahweh	infinite reward	infinite punishment
You worship Allah	infinite punishment	infinite reward

In reply, Pascalians offer a number of defenses.

a. Genuine Options

Some Pascalians insist that only certain theological possibilities count as “genuine options” (James 1897, Jordan 1994b), although this notion is never clearly defined. Perhaps a proposition P is a genuine option for some subject S only if S is likely to succeed in believing P, should S choose to. However, the relevance of volition is questionable, as discussed in the previous section. Alternatively, perhaps P is a genuine option for S unless P strikes S as “bizarre” or untraditional (Jordan 1994b). The difficulty here lies in distinguishing this position from emotional prejudice (Saka 2001). Finally, it may be that a genuine option is one that possesses sufficient evidential support, in which case it can then participate in a run-off decision procedure.

b. Run-off Decision Theory

Some Pascalians propose combining pragmatic and epistemic factors in a two-stage process. First, one uses epistemic considerations in selecting a limited set of belief options, then one uses prudential considerations in choosing among them (Jordan 1994b). Alternatively, one first uses prudential considerations to choose religion over non-religion, and then uses epistemic considerations to choose a particular religion (Schlesinger 1994, Jordan 1993).

In order to be at all plausible, this approach must answer two questions. First, what is the justification for deliberately excluding some possibilities, no matter how improbable, from prudential reasoning? It seems irrational to dismiss some options that are acknowledged to be possible, even be they unlikely, so long as the stakes are sufficiently high (Sorensen 1994). Second, can epistemic considerations work without begging the question? Schlesinger argues that the Principle of Sufficient Reason gives some support for believing in God, but in a Pascalian context this is questionable. If you subscribe to a suitable form of the Principle of Sufficient Reason (one that leads to a given kind of theism), you are likely to be a theist already and hence Pascal’s wager does not apply to you; on the other hand, if you do not believe in the right kind of Principle of Sufficient Reason, then you will not think that it makes theism more probable than atheistic Buddhism, or anthropomorphic theism more probable than deism. Other epistemic considerations, such as Schlesinger’s appeal to testimony, simplicity, and sublimity, meet with analogous challenges (Amico 1994, Saka 2001).

c. Relativism

Some Pascalians, while acknowledging that the Wager might be unsound for today’s multi-culturally sophisticated audience, maintain that the Wager is sound relative to Pascal and his peers in the 1600s, when Catholicism and agnosticism were the only possibilities (Rescher 1985, Franklin 1998). But the Crusades in the 1100s taught the French of Islam, the Renaissance in the 1400s taught the French of Greco-Roman paganism, the discoveries of the 1500s taught the French of new-world paganism, and several wars of religion taught the French of Protestantism. To claim that the educated French of the 1600s rightfully rejected alien beliefs without consideration appears to endorse rank prejudice.

d. Generic Theism

Some acknowledge that Pascal’s wager cannot decide among religions, yet maintain that “it at least gets us to theism” (Jordan 1994b, Armour-Garb 1999). The idea is that Catholics, Protestants, Jews, Moslems, and devil-worshippers can all legitimately use decision theory to conclude that it is best to believe in some supreme being. Against this there are two objections. First, it disregards theological possibilities such as the Professor’s God. The Professor’s God rewards those who humbly remain skeptical in the absence of evidence, and punishes those who adopt theism on the basis of self-interest (Martin 1975, 1990; Mackie 1982). Second, the claim that Pascal’s wager yields generic theism assumes that all religions are theistic. But consider the following sort of atheistic Buddhism: if you clear your mind then you will attain nirvana and otherwise you will not — that is, if you fill your mind with thoughts and desires, such as believing that God exists or living God, then you will not attain salvation (Saka 2001).

4. The Evidentialist Objection: Is Prudential Reasoning Ethical

There are two versions of this objection that need to be kept distinct. The first one suggests that Pascalian reasoners are manipulative egoists whom God might take exception to, and they won’t be rewarded after all (Nicholl 1978). Schlesinger 1994 responds by saying that any reasoning that gets us to believe in God, if God exists, cannot be bad. But this argument seems to depend on the nature of God. If God holds that results are all that matter, that the ends justify the means, then Schlesinger is right. But maybe God holds that true beliefs count as meritorious only if they are based on good evidence; maybe God rewards only evidentialists. In short, this form of the objection is just another version of the many-gods objection.

Another form of evidentialism refers not to God’s character but to our own. Regardless of how God might or might not reward our decisions, it may be categorically, epistemically or otherwise wrong — “absolutely wicked”, in the words of G.E. Moore — for us to base any belief on decision-theoretic self-interest (Clifford 1879, Nicholls 1978).

Since utilitarians would tend to favor Pascalian reasoning while Kantians and virtue ethicists would not, the issue at stake belongs to a much larger debate in moral philosophy.

5. The Paradox Objection: Is Decision Theory Coherent?

a. The Equi-utility Paradox

If you regularly brush your teeth, there is some chance you will go to heaven and enjoy infinite bliss. On the other hand, there is some chance you will enjoy infinite heavenly bliss even if you do not brush your teeth. Therefore the expectation of brushing your teeth (infinity plus a little extra due to oral health = infinity) is the same as that of not brushing your teeth (infinity minus a bit due to cavities and gingivitis = infinity), from which it follows that dental hygiene is not a particularly prudent course of action. In fact, as soon as we allow infinite utilities, decision theory tells us that any course of action is as good as any other (Duff 1986). Hence we have a reductio ad absurdum against decision theory, at least when it’s extended to infinite cases. In reply to such difficulties, Jordan 1993 proposes a run-off decision theory as described above.

b. The St. Petersburg Paradox

Imagine tossing a coin until it lands heads-up, and suppose that the payoff grows exponentially according to the number of tosses you make. If the coin lands heads-up on the first toss then the payoff is $2; if it takes two tosses then the payoff is $4; if it takes three tosses then the payoff is $8; and so forth, ad infinitum. Now the odds of the game ending on the first toss is 1/2; of ending on the second toss, 1/4; on the third, 1/8; and so forth. Since there is a one-half chance of winning $2, plus a quarter chance of winning $4, plus a one-eighth chance of winning $8, and so forth, your expectation for playing the game is (1/2 x $2) + (1/4 x $4) + (1/8 x $8) +…, that is, $1 + $1 + $1… = infinity! It follows you should be willing to pay any finite amount for the privilege of playing this game. Yet it clearly seems irrational to pay very much at all. The conclusion is that decision theory is a bad guide when infinite values are involved (for discussion of this very old paradox, see Sorensen 1994). Byl (1994) points out that instead of referring to infinite payoffs we can speak of arbitrarily high ones. No matter how improbable be the existence of God, it is still decision-theoretically rational to believe in God if the reward for doing so is sufficiently, yet only finitely, high. However, this does not address the heart of the problem, for the St. Petersburg paradox too may be cast in terms of an arbitrarily high limit. Intuitively, one would not be willing to pay a million dollars, say, for the privilege of playing a game capped at one-million-and-one coin tosses, and it is not just because of the diminishing value of money. There is something unsettling about decision theory, at least as applied to extreme cases, and so we might be skeptical about using it as a basis for religious commitment.

6. References and Further Reading

The best known defense of Pascal is Lycan & Schlesinger 1989; for responses see Amico 1994 and Saka 2001. A good sourcebook is Jordan 1994a.

Amico, Robert (1994) “Pascal’s wager revisited”, International Studies in Philosophy 26:1-11.
Armour-Garb, Bradley (1999) “Betting on God”, Religious Studies 35:119-38.
Byl, John (1994) “On Pascal’s wager and infinite utilities”, Faith & Philosophy 11:467-73.
Clifford, William (1879) “The ethics of belief”, Lectures & Essays, Macmillan.
Duff, Anthony (1986) “Pascal’s wager and infinite utilities”, Analysis 46:107-09.
Franklin, James (1998) “Two caricatures, I: Pascal’s wager”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 44:115-19.
Hacking, Ian (1972) “The logic of Pascal’s wager”, reprinted in Jordan 1994a.
James, William (1897) “The will to believe”, reprinted in The Will to Believe and Other Essays, Dover.
Jordan, Jeff (1991) “The many-gods objection and Pascal’s wager”, International Philosophical Quarterly 31:309-17.
Jordan, Jeff (1993) “Pascal’s wager and the problem of infinite utilities”, Faith & Philosophy 10:49-59.
Jordan, Jeff, editor (1994a) Gambling on God, Lanham MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
Jordan, Jeff (1994b) “The many-gods objection”, in Jordan 1994a; a restatement of Jordan 1991.
Lycan, William & George Schlesinger (1989) “You bet your life”, in Reason & Responsibility, 7^th edition (ed. Joel Feinberg, Belmont CA: Wadsworth). Also in the 8^th, 9^th, 10^th editions; in Philosophy and the Human Condition, 2^d edition (ed. Tom Beauchamp et al., Englewood Cliffs NJ: Prentice Hall, 1989); and in Contemporary Perspectives on Religious Epistemology (ed. Douglas Geivet & Brendan Sweetmar, Oxford, 1993). See also Schlesinger 1994.
Mackie, J.L. (1982) The Miracle of Theism, Oxford, pp. 200-03.
Martin, Michael (1975) “On four critiques of Pascal’s wager”, Sophia 14:1-11.
Martin, Michael (1990) Atheism, Philadelphia: Temple University Press, pp. 229-38.
Mougin, Gregory & Elliott Sober (1994) “Betting on Pascal’s wager”, Nous 28:382-95.
Nicholl, Larimore (1978) “Pascal’s Wager: The bet is off”, Philosophy & Phenomenological Research 39:274-80.
Pascal, Blaise (composed in 1600s, first published in 1800s) Pensees, section 343; translated & reprinted by Penguin and many others.
Rescher, Nicholas (1985) Pascal’s Wager, University of Notre Dame Press.
Saka, Paul (2001) “Pascal’s wager and the many gods objection”, Religious Studies 37:321-41.
Schlesinger, George (1994) “A central theistic argument”, in Jordan 1994a; a restatement of Lycan & Schlesinger 1989.
Sorensen, Roy (1994) “Infinite decision theory”, in Jordan 1994a.

Author Information

Paul Saka
Email: paul-saka@live.com
University of Texas, Rio Grande
U. S. A.

Logical Paradoxes

paradox_logical A paradox is generally a puzzling conclusion we seem to be driven towards by our reasoning, but which is highly counterintuitive, nevertheless. There are, among these, a large variety of paradoxes of a logical nature which have teased even professional logicians, in some cases for several millennia. But what are now sometimes isolated as “the logical paradoxes” are a much less heterogeneous collection: they are a group of antinomies centered on the notion of self-reference, some of which were known in Classical times, but most of which became particularly prominent in the early decades of last century. Quine distinguished amongst paradoxes such antinomies. He did so by first isolating the “veridical” and “falsidical” paradoxes, which, although puzzling riddles, turned out to be plainly true, or plainly false, after some inspection. In addition, however, there were paradoxes which “produce a self-contradiction by accepted ways of reasoning,” and which, Quine thought, established “that some tacit and trusted pattern of reasoning must be made explicit, and henceforward be avoided or revised.” We will first look, more broadly, and historically, at several of the main conundrums of a logical nature which have proved difficult, some since antiquity, before concentrating later on the more recent troubles with paradoxes of self-reference. They will all be called “logical paradoxes.”

Classical Logical Paradoxes
Moving to Modern Times
Some Recent Logical Paradoxes
Paradoxes of Self-Reference
A Contemporary Twist
References and Further Reading

1. Classical Logical Paradoxes

The four main paradoxes attributed to Eubulides, who lived in the fourth century BC, were “The Liar,” “The Hooded Man,” “The Heap,” and “The Horned Man” (compare Kneale and Kneale 1962, p114).

The Horned Man is a version of the “When did you stop beating your wife?” puzzle. This is not a simple question, and needs a carefully phrased reply, to avoid the inevitable come-back to “I have not.” How is one to understand this denial, as saying you continue to beat your wife, or that you once did but do so no longer, or that you never have, and never will? It is a question of what the “not,” or negation means, in this case. If “stopped beating” means “beat before, but no longer,” then “not stopped beating” covers both “did not beat before” and “continues to beat.” And in that case “I haven’t” is an entirely correct answer to the question, if you in fact did not beat your wife. However, your audience might still need to be taken slowly through the alternatives before they clearly see this. Likewise with the Horned Man, which arises if someone wants to say, for instance, “what you have not lost you still have.” In that case they will maybe have to accept the unwelcome conclusion “I still have horns,” if they admit “I have not lost any horns.” Here, if “lost” means “had, but do not still have” then “not lost” would cover the alternative “did not have in the first place” as well as “do still have” — in which case what you have not lost you do not necessarily still have.

The Heap is nowadays commonly referred to as the Sorites Paradox, and concerns the possibility that the borderline between a predicate and its negation need not be finely drawn. We would all say that a man with no hairs on his head was bald, and that a man with, say, 10,000 hairs on his head was hirsute, that is not bald, but what about a man with only 1,000 hairs on his head, which are, say, evenly spread? It is not too clear what we should say, although maybe some would still want to say positively “bald,” while others would want to say “not bald.” The learned treatment of this issue, in recent years, has been very extensive, with “the lazy solution” not being the only one favoured, by any means. The lazy solution says that any lack of certainty about what to say is merely a matter of us not having yet decided upon, or even having the need to make up our mind about, a “precisification” of the concept of baldness. There are objectors to this “epistemic” way of seeing the matter, some of whom would prefer to think, for instance (see, e.g. Sainsbury 1995), that there was something essentially “fuzzy” about baldness, so it is a “vague predicate” by the nature of things, instead of just through lack of effort, or need. (For recent work in this area, see, for instance, Williamson 1994, and Keefe 2001).

The Hooded Man is about the concept of knowledge, and in other versions has again been much studied in recent years, as we shall see. In its original version the problem is this: maybe you would be prepared to say that you know your brother, yet surely someone might come in, who was in fact your brother, but with his head covered, so you did not know who it was. One aspect of this paradox is that the verb “know” is ambiguous, and in fact is translated by two separate terms in several other languages than English — French, for instance, has “connâitre” and “savoir.” There is the sense of “being acquainted with,” in other words, and the sense of “knowing a fact about something.” Perhaps these two senses are inter-related, but distinguishing them provides one way out of the Hooded Man. For we can distinguish being acquainted with your brother from knowing that someone is your brother. Although you do not know it, you are certainly acquainted with the hooded man, since he is your brother, and you are acquainted with your brother. But that does not entail that you know that the hooded man is your brother, indeed, evidently you do not. We could also say, in that case, that you did not recognize your brother, for the notion of recognition is close to that of knowledge. And that points to another aspect of the problem, and another way of resolving the paradox — showing, in addition, that there needn’t just be one solution, or way out. Thus you might well be able to recognise your brother, but that does not require you can always do so, it merely means you can do better at this than those people who cannot do so. If we re-phrase the case: “you can recognise your brother, but you did not recognise him when he had his head covered,” then there is not really a paradox.

The last of Eubulides’ paradoxes mentioned above was The Liar, which is perhaps the most famous paradox in the “self-reference” family. The basic idea had several variations, even in antiquity. There was, for instance, The Cretan, where Epimenides, a Cretan, says that all Cretans are liars, and The Crocodile, where a crocodile has stolen someone’s child, and says to him “I will return her to you if you guess correctly whether I will do so or not” — to which the father says “You will not return my child”! Indeed a whole host of complications of The Liar have been constructed, especially in the last century, as we shall see. Now in The Cretan there is no real antinomy — it may simply be false that all Cretans are liars; but if someone says just “I am lying,” the situation is different. For if it is true that he is lying then seemingly what he says is false; but if it is false that he is lying then what he is saying may seem to be true. A pedant might say that “lying” was strictly not telling an untruth, but telling merely what one believes to be an untruth. In that case there is not the same difficulty with the person’s remark being true: maybe he is indeed lying, although he does not believe it. The pedant, however, misses the point that his verbal nicety can be circumvented, and the paradox re-constructed in another, indeed many other forms. We shall look in more detail later at the paradox here, in some of its more complicated versions.

Before leaving the ancients, however, we can look at Zeno’s Paradoxes, which not only have a logical interest in their own right, but also have a very close bearing on some paradoxes which appeared later, to do with infinity, and infinitesimals. Zeno’s Paradoxes are primarily about the possibility of motion, but more generally they are about the possibility of specifying the units, or atomic parts, of which either space or time, or indeed any continuum may be thought to be composed.

For, Zeno argued (see, for instance, Owen 1957, and Salmon 1970), if there were such units then they would either have a size, or not have a size. But if they had a size we would have the paradox of The Stadium, while if they had no size we would have the paradox of The Arrow. Thus if runners A and B are approaching one another both at unit speed, then, supposing the units have a finite size, after one time unit they will have each moved one space unit relative to the stadium. But they will have moved two space units relative to each other, which implies that there was a time unit in between when they were just one space unit apart. So the time unit must be divisible after all. On the other hand, if the units of division have no size, then, at any given time, an arrow in flight must occupy a space just equal to itself — for it cannot move within that time. But if so then it is at rest, and the arrow never moves.

That would seem to mean that space and time are divided without limit. But Zeno argued that if space and time were in themselves divided without limit then we would have the paradox of Achilles and the Tortoise. A runner, before he gets to the end of his race would have to get to the half-way point, but then also to the half-way point beyond that, that is the three-quarter-way point, and so on. There would be no limit to the sequence of points he would have to get to, and so there would always be a bit more to be run, and he could never get to the end. Likewise in a competitive race, even, say, between the super-speedy Achilles and a tortoise: Achilles would not be able to catch the tortoise up — so long as the tortoise was given a start. For Achilles has first to get to the tortoise’s original position, but by then the tortoise will be, however fractionally, further on. Now Achilles must always reach the tortoise’s previous position before catching him up. Hence he never catches it up.

Aristotle had a way of resolving Zeno’s Paradoxes which convinced most people until more recent times. Aristotle’s resolution of Zeno’s Paradoxes involved distinguishing between space and time being in themselves divided into parts without limit, and simply being divisible (by ourselves, for instance) without limit. No continuous magnitude, Aristotle thought, is actually composed of parts, since, although it may be divisible into parts without limit, the continuum is given before any such resulting division into parts. In particular, Aristotle denied that there could be any non-finite parts, and so is often called a “Finitist”: non-finite “parts” cannot be parts of space or time, he thought, since no magnitude can be composed of what has no extension. This view came to be challenged later, since it means that an arrow can only be “at rest” if it is at the same place at two separate times — for Aristotle both rest and motion can only be defined over a finite increment of time. But later the notion of an instantaneous velocity came to be accepted, and that includes the case where the velocity is zero.

The puzzle about non-finite parts may remind one of the question which occupied many scholastic theologians in the Middle Ages: how many angels can sit upon a pin? And it is perhaps no accident that the theorist who gave the currently received answer to the general question of how many things without any extension make up a whole which has such an extension was a fervent believer in God. Certainly Aristotle’s Finitism only stayed generally persuasive until the latter end of the nineteenth century, when the theorist in question, Cantor, specified the number of non-finite points in a continuum to most learned people’s satisfaction.

2. Moving to Modern Times

Between the classical times of Aristotle and the late nineteenth century when Cantor worked, there was a period in the middle ages when paradoxes of a logical kind were considered intensively. That was during the fourteenth century. Notable individuals were Paul of Venice, living towards the end of that century, and John Buridan, born just before it. As models of the care, and clarity which is required to extricate oneself from the above kind of difficulties with problem propositions each of these writers will surely stand forever. As an illustration, Buridan discusses “No change is instantaneous” in the following way (Scott 1966, p178):

I prove it, because every change is either in an indivisible instant or it is in a divisible time. But none is in an indivisible instant, since an indivisible instant cannot be given in time, as is always supposed. Hence every change is in divisible time, and every such must be called temporal and not instantaneous.

The opposite is argued, because at least the creation of our intellective soul is instantaneous. For since it is indivisible, it must be made altogether at once, not one part after another. And such creation we call instantaneous. Therefore.

Buridan also discusses “You know the one approaching,” which resembles Eubulides’ Hooded Man (Scott 1966, p178):

I posit the case that you see your father coming from a distance, in such a way that you do not discern whether it is your father or another.Then it is proved, because you do indeed know your father, and he is the one approaching; hence, you know the one approaching. Likewise, you know him who is known by you, but the one approaching is known by you; hence, you know the one approaching. I prove the minor, because your father is known by you and your father is the one approaching; hence, the one approaching is known by you.

The opposite is argued, because you do not know him of whom, if you are asked who he is, you will answer truly “I do not know.” But concerning the one approaching you say this; hence etc.

These two cases are “sophisms” in Buridan’s book on such, Sophismata, and amongst these, in chapter 8, are the “insolubles,” which are the ones involving some form of self-reference. Broadly speaking, that is to say, Buridan made a distinction similar to that mentioned before, between general paradoxes of a logical nature, and “the logical paradoxes.” Thus in his chapter 8 Buridan discusses Eubulides’ Liar Paradox in several forms, for instance as it arises with “Every proposition is false” in the following circumstances (Scott 1966, p191): “I posit the case that all true propositions should be destroyed and false ones remain. And then Socrates utters only this proposition: ‘Every proposition is false’.”

Extended discussion of such cases may seem somewhat academic, but between Buridan’s period, and more recent times, one notable figure started to bring out something of the larger importance of these issues. Indeed, quite generally, sophisms about the nature of change and continuity, about knowledge and its objects, and the ones about the notion of self-reference, amongst many others, have attracted a great deal of very professional attention, once their significance was realised, with techniques of analysis drawn from developments in formal logic and linguistic studies being added to the careful and clear expression, and modes of argument found in the best writers before. The pace of change started to quicken in the later nineteenth century, but the one earlier thinker who will also be mentioned here is Bishop Berkeley, who was active in the early eighteenth. For a history of this period, in connection with the issues which concerned Berkeley, see, for instance, Grattan-Guinness 1980. Berkeley’s argument was with Newton about the foundations of the calculus; he took, amongst other things, a sceptical line about the possibility of instantaneous velocities.

It will be remembered that in the calculation of a derivative the following fraction is considered:

f(x + δx) – f(x) / δx,

where δx is a very small quantity.In the elementary case where f(x) = x², for instance, we get

(x + δx)² – x² / δx,

and the calculation goes first to

2xδx+ δx²/ δx,

and then to 2x + δx, with δx being subsequently set to zero to get the exact derivative 2x.Berkeley objected that only if δx was not zero could one first divide through by it, and so one was in no position, with the result of that operation, to then take δx to be zero.If it took δx to be zero Newton’s calculus, it seemed, required the impossible notion of an instantaneous velocity, which, of course, Aristotle had denied in connection with his analysis of Zeno’s Paradoxes.The point was appreciated to some extent elsewhere.For the association between the derivative and motion, initiated by Newton’s use of the term “fluxion,” was largely confined to England, and on the Continent, Leibniz’ cotemporaneous development of the calculus had more hold.And that involved the idea that the increment δx was never zero, but merely remained a still finite “infinitesimal.”

One way of putting Aristotle’s Finitism is to say that he believed that infinities, such as the possible successive divisions of a line, were only “potential,” not “actual” — an actual infinite division would end up with non-extensional, and so non-finite points. Leibniz, however, had no problem with the notion of an actual infinite division of a line — or with the idea that the result could be a finite quantity. However, while Leibniz introduced finite infinitesimals instead of fluxions, this idea was also questioned as not sufficiently rigorous, and both ideas lost ground to definitions of derivatives in terms of limits, by Cauchy and Weierstrass in the nineteenth century. Leibniz’ notion of finite infinitesimals in fact has been given a more rigorous definition since that time, by Abraham Robinson, and other proponents of “non-standard analysis,” but it was on the previous, nineteenth century theory of real numbers that Cantor worked, before he came to formulate his theory of infinite numbers. Leibniz would not have thought it too sensible to ask how many of his infinitesimals made up the line, but Cantor made much more precise the answer “infinitely many.”

It is necessary to get some idea about the theory of real numbers before we can understand the next logical paradoxes which emerged in this tradition: Russell’s Paradox, Burali-Forti’s Paradox, Cantor’s Paradox, and Skolem’s Paradox. We will look at those in the next section, which will then lead us into twentieth century developments in the area of self-reference. But before all that it should be mentioned how recent discussions of knowledge and its objects, for instance, has become very professionalised, since developed discussion of issues to do with Eubulides’ Hooded Man has been just as dominant in this period.

These issues, it will be remembered, centred on the problem of non-recognition, and in various ways two central cases of this have been given close attention since the end of the nineteenth century. A great deal of other relevant discussion has also gone on, but these two cases are perhaps the most important, historically (see, for example, Linsky 1967). First must be mentioned Frege’s interest in the difficulty of inferring someone believes something about the Evening Star so long as they believe that thing about the Morning Star. In fact the Morning Star is the same as the Evening Star, we now realise, but this was not always recognised, and indeed it is now realised that even the term “star” is a misnomer, both objects being the planet Venus. Still someone ignorant of the astronomical identity, it may be thought, might accept “The Evening Star is in the sky,” but reject “The Morning Star is in the sky.” Quine produced another much discussed case of a similar sort, concerning Bernard J. Ortcutt, a respectable man with grey hair, once seen at the beach. In one location he was taken to be not a spy, in another place he was taken to be a spy, as one might say; but is that quite the best way the situation should be described? Maybe one who does not recognise him can have beliefs about the man at the beach without thereby having those beliefs about the respectable man with grey hair — or even Bernard J. Ortcutt. Certainly Quine thought so, which has not only caused a large scale controversy in itself; it has also led to, or been part of much broader discussions about identity in similar, but non-personal, intensional notions, like modality. Thus, as Quine pointed out, it would not seem to be necessary that the number of the planets is greater than 4, although it is necessary that 9 is greater than 4, and 9 is the number of the planets. A branch of formal logic, Intensional Logic, has been developed to enable a more precise analysis of these kinds of issue.

3. Some Recent Logical Paradoxes

It was developments in other parts of mathematics which were integral to the discovery of the next logical paradoxes to be considered. These were developments in the theory of real numbers, as was mentioned before, but also in Set Theory, and Arithmetic. Arithmetic is now taken to be concerned with a “denumerable” number of objects — the natural numbers — while real numbers are “non-denumerable.” Sets of both infinite sizes can be formed, it is now thought, which is the basis on which Cantor was to give his precise answer “two to the aleph zero” to the question of how many points there are on a line.

The tradition up to the middle of the nineteenth century did not look at these matters in this kind of way. For the natural numbers arise in connection with counting, for instance counting the cows in a field. If there are a number of cows in the field then there is a set of them: sets are collections of such individuals. But with the beef in the field we do not normally talk in these terms: “beef” is a mass noun not a count noun, and so it does not individuate things, merely name some stuff, and, as a result, a number can be associated with the beef in the field only given some arbitrary unit, like a pound, or a kilogram. When there is just some F then there isn’t a number of F’s, although there might be a number of, say, pieces of F. It is the same with continua like space and time, which we can divide into yards, or seconds, or indeed any finite quantity, and that is perhaps the main fact which supports Aristotle’s view that any division of such a continuum is merely potential rather than actual, and inevitably finite both in the unit used and in the number of them in a whole.

But continua from Cantor onwards have been seen as composed of non-finite individuals. And not only that is the change. For also the number of individuals in some set of individuals — whether cows, or the non-finite elements in beef — has been taken to be possibly non-finite, with a whole containing those individuals being then still available: the infinite set of them. We now commonly have the idea that there may be infinite sets first of finite entities, which will then be “countable” or “denumerable,” but also there will be sets of non-finite, infinitesimal entities, which will be “uncountable,” or “non-denumerable.”

It is important to appreciate the grip that these new ideas had on the late nineteenth century generation of mathematicians and logicians, since it came to seem, as a result of these sorts of changes, that everything in mathematics was going to be explainable in terms of sets: Set Theory looked like it would become the entire foundation for mathematics. Only once one has appreciated this expectation, which the vanguard of theorists uniformly had, can one realise the very severe jolt to that society which came with the discovery of Russell’s Paradox, and several others at much the same time, around the turn of the century. For Russell’s Paradox showed that not everything could be a set.

If we write “x is F” as “Fx”—as came to be common in this same period—then the set of F’s is written

{x|Fx},

and to say a is F, that is Fa, would then seem to be to say that a belonged to this set, that is

a ∈ {x|Fx},

where the symbol “∈” represents “is a member of.”

It therefore seems plausible to enunciate this as a general principle,

for all y: y ∈ {x|Fx} if and only if Fy,

which is symbolised in contemporary logic,

(y)(y ∈ {x|Fx} iff Fy).

But if the result held for all predicates “F” then we could say, for any “F”

there is a z such that: (y)(y ∈ z iff Fy),

which is now formalised

(∃>z)(y)(y ∈ z iff Fy).

In the foundations of Arithmetic which Frege described in his major logical works Begriffsschrift, and Grundgesetze, this principle is a major axiom (Kneale and Kneale 1962, Ch 8), but Russell found it was logically impossible, since if one takes for “Fy” the specific predicate “y does not belong to y,” that is “¬ y ∈ y” then it requires

(∃>z)(y)(y ∈ z iff ¬ y ∈ y),

wherefrom, given the above meanings of “(∃>z)” and “(y)”, we get the contradiction

z ∈ z iff ¬ z ∈ z,

that is z is a member of itself if and only if it is not a member of itself. As a result of this paradox which Russell discovered, the theory of sets was considerably altered, and limits were put on Frege’s axiom, so that, for instance, either it defined merely subsets of known sets (Zermelo’s theory), or allowed one to discriminate sets from other entities — usually called “proper classes” (von Neumann’s theory). In the latter case those things which are not members of themselves form a proper class but not a set, and proper classes cannot be members of anything.

But there were other reasons why it came to be realised that sets could not always be formed, following the discovery of Burali-Forti’s and Cantor’s Paradoxes. Burali-Forti’s Paradox is about certain sets called “ordinals,” because of their connection with the ordinals of ordinary language, that is “first,” “second,” “third,” etc. The sets which are ordinals are so ordered that each one is a member of all the following ones, and so, with no limit envisaged to the sets which could be formed, it seemed possible to prove that any succession of such ordinals would themselves be members of a further ordinal – which would have to be distinct from each of them. The trouble came in considering the totality of all ordinals, since that would mean that there would have to be a further distinct ordinal not in this totality, and yet it was supposed to be the totality of all ordinals. A very similar contradiction is reached in Cantor’s Paradox.

For, for finite sets of finite entities it is easy to prove Cantor’s Theorem, namely that the number of members of a set is strictly less than the number of its subsets. If one forms a set of the subsets of a given set then one produces the “power set” of the original set, so another way of stating Cantor’s Theorem is to say that the number of members of a set is strictly less than the number of members of its power set. Cantor extended this theorem to his infinite sets as well – although there was at least one such set he realised it obviously could not apply to, namely the set of everything, sometimes called the universal set. For the set of its subsets clearly could not have a greater number than the number of things in the universal set itself, since that contained everything. This was Cantor’s Paradox, and his resolution of it was to say that such an infinity was “inconsistent,” since it could not be consistently numbered. He thought, however, that only the size of infinite sets had to be limited, assuming that lesser infinities could be consistently numbered, and nominating, for a start, “aleph zero” as the number, or more properly the “power” of the natural numbers (Hallett 1984, p175). In fact an earlier paradox about the natural numbers had suggested that even they could not be consistently numbered: for they could be put into 1 to 1 correlation with the even numbers, for one thing, and yet there were surely more of them, since they included the odd numbers as well. This paradox Cantor took to be avoided by his definition of the power of a set (N.B. not the power set of a set): his definition merely required two sets to be put into 1 to 1 correlation in order for them to have the same power. Thus all infinite sequences of natural numbers have the same power, aleph zero.

But the number of points in a line was not aleph zero, it was two to the aleph zero, and Cantor produced several proofs that these were not the same. The most famous was his diagonal argument which seems to show that there must be orders of infinity, and specifically that the non-denumerably infinite is distinct from the denumerably infinite. For belief in real numbers is equivalent to belief in certain infinite sets: real numbers are commonly understood simply in terms of possibly-non-terminating decimals, but this definition can be derived from the more theoretical ones (Suppes 1972, p189). But can the decimals between, say, 0 and 1 be listed? Listing them would make them countable in the special sense of this which has been adopted, which amongst other things does not require there to be a last item counted. The natural numbers are countable in this sense, as before, and any list, it seems, can be indexed by the ordinal numbers. Suppose, however, that we had a list in which the n-th member was of this form:

a_n = 0.a_n1a_n2a_n3a_n4…,

where a_ni is a digit between 0 and 9 inclusive.Then that list would not contain the “diagonal” decimal a_m defined by

a_mn = 9 – a_nn,

since for n = m this equation is false, if only whole digits are involved. This seems to show that the totality of decimals in any continuous interval cannot be listed, which implies that there are at least two separate orders of infinity.

Of course, if there were no infinite sets then there would be no infinite numbers, countable or uncountable, and so an Aristotelian would not accept the result of this proof as a fact. Discrete things might, at the most, be potentially denumerable, for him. But the difficulty with the result extends even to those who accept that there are infinite sets, because of another paradox, Skolem’s Paradox, which shows that all theories of a certain sort must have a countable model, that is must be true in some countable domain of objects. But Set Theory is one such theory, and in it, supposedly, there must be non-countable sets. In fact a denumerable model for Set Theory has recently been specified, by Lavine (Lavine 1994), so how can Cantor’s diagonal proof be accommodated? Commonly it is accommodated by saying that, within the denumerable model of Set Theory, non-denumerability is represented merely by the absence of a function which can do the indexing of a set, that is produce a correlation between the set and the ordinal numbers. But if that is the case, then maybe the difficulty of listing the real numbers in an interval is comparable. Certainly given a list of real numbers with a functional way of indexing them, then diagonalisation enables us to construct another real number. But maybe there still might be a denumerable number of all the real numbers in an interval without any possibility of finding a function which lists them, in which case we would have no diagonal means of producing another. We seem to need a further proof that being denumerable in size means being listable by means of a function.

4. Paradoxes of Self-Reference

The possibility that Cantor’s diagonal procedure is a paradox in its own right is not usually entertained, although a direct application of it does yield an acknowledged paradox: Richard’s Paradox. Consider for a start all finite sequences of the twenty six letters of the English alphabet, the ten digits, a comma, a full stop, a dash and a blank space. Order these expressions according, first, to the number of symbols, and then lexicographically within each such set. We then have a way of identifying the n-th member of this collection. Now some of these expressions are English phrases, and some of those phrases will define real numbers. Let E be the sub-collection which does this, and suppose we can again identify the n-th place in this, for each natural number n. Then the following phrase, as Richard pointed out, would seem to define a real number which is not defined in the collection: “The real number whose whole part is zero, and whose n-th decimal place is p plus 1 if the n-th decimal of the real number defined by the n-th member of E is p, and p is neither 8 or 9, and is simply one if this n-th decimal is eight or nine.” But this expression is a finite sequence of the previously described kind.

One significant fact about this paradox is that it is a semantical paradox, since it is concerned not just with the ordered collection of expressions (which is a syntactic matter), but also their meaning, that is whether they refer to real numbers. It is this which possibly makes it unclear whether there is a specifiable list of expressions of the required kind, since while the total list of expressions can certainly be straightforwardly ordered, whether some expression defines a real number is maybe not such a clear cut matter. Indeed, it might be concluded, just from the very fact that a paradox ensues, as above, that whether some English phrase defines a real number is not always entirely settleable. In Borel’s terms, it cannot be decided effectively (Martin-Löf 1970, p44). Another very similar semantical paradox with this same aspect is Berry’s Paradox, about “the least integer not nameable in fewer than nineteen syllables.” The problem here is that that very phrase has less than nineteen syllables in it, and yet, if it names an integer, that integer would have to be not nameable in less than nineteen syllables. So is there a definite set of English expressions which name integers not nameable in less than nineteen syllables?

If some sort of fuzziness was the case then there would be a considerable difference between such paradoxes and the previous paradoxes in logical theory like Russell’s, Burali-Forti’s and Cantor’s, for instance. Indeed it has been common since Ramsey’s discussion of these matters, in the 1920s, to divide the major logical paradoxes into two: the semantic or linguistic on the one hand, and the syntactic or mathematical on the other. Mackie disagreed with Ramsey to a certain extent, although he was prepared to say (Mackie 1973, p262):

The semantical paradoxes…can thus be solved in a philosophical sense by demonstrating the lack of content of the key items, the fact that various questions and sentences, construed in the intended way, raise no substantial issue. But these are comments appropriate only to linguistic items; one would expect that this method would apply only to the semantic paradoxes, and not to “syntactic” ones like Russell’s class paradox, which are believed to involve only (formal) logical and mathematical elements.

Russell himself opposed the distinction, formulating his famous “Vicious Circle Principle” which, he held, all the paradoxes of self-reference violated. Specifically he held that statements about all the members of certain collections were nonsense (compare Haack 1978, p141):

Whatever involves all of a collection must not be one of a collection, or, conversely, if, provided a certain collection had a total it would have members only definable in terms of that total, then the said collection has no total.

But this, seemingly, would rule out specifying, for instance, a man as the one with the highest batting average in his team, since he is then defined in terms of a total of which he is a member. It effectively imposes a ban on all forms of self-reference, and so Russell’s uniform solution to the paradoxes is usually thought to be too drastic. Some might say “this may be using a cannon against a fly, but at least it stops the fly!”; but it also devastates too much else in the vicinity.

A more recent theorist to oppose Ramsey’s distinction has been Priest. In fact he has tried to prove that all the main paradoxes of self-reference have a common structure using a further insight of Russell’s, which he calls “Russell’s Schema” (Priest 1994, p27). This pre-dates Russell’s attachment to the Vicious Circle Principle, but Priest has shown that, when adapted and applied to all the main paradoxes, it matches the reasoning which leads to the contradiction in each one of them. This approach, however, presumes that semantical notions, like definability, designation, truth, and knowledge can be construed in terms of mathematical sets, which seems to be really the very supposition which Ramsey disputed.

Grelling’s Paradox also makes this supposition questionable. It is a self-referential, semantical paradox resembling, to some extent, Russell’s Paradox, and concerns the property which an adjective has if it does not apply to itself. Thus

“large” is not large,
“multi-syllabled” is multi-syllabled,
“English” is English,
“French” is not French.

Let us use the term “heterological” for the property of being non-self-applicable, so we can say that “large” and “French” are heterological, for instance, and we can write as a general definition

“x” is heterological if and only if “x” is not x.

But clearly, substituting “heterological” for “x” produces a contradiction. Does this contradiction mean there is no such concept as heterologicality, just as there is no such set as the Russell set? Goldstein has recently argued that this is so (Goldstein 2000, p67), following a tradition Mackie calls “the logical proof approach” (Mackie 1973, p254f), to which Ryle was a notable contributor (Ryle 1950-1). The point is made even more plausible given the very detailed logical analysis which Copi provided (Copi 1973, p301).

Copi first introduces the definition

Hs =_df (∃>F)(sDesF&(P)(sDesP iff P=F) & ¬Fs),

in which “¬” abbreviates “not”, and “Des” refers to the relation between a verbal expression and the property it designates. Thus “sDesF” reads: s designates F. Copi’s proof of the contradiction then goes in the following way. First, H”H” entails in turn

(∃>F)(“H”DesF&(P)(“H”DesP iff P=F)&¬F”H”) – by substitution in the definition,

“H”DesF&(P)(“H”DesP iff P=F)&¬F”H” – by taking the case thus said to exist,

(“H”DesH iff H=F)&¬F”H” – by substitution in the “for all P”,

H=F&¬F”H” – by assuming “H” designates H,

Then ¬H”H” entails in turn

(F)¬(“H”DesF&(P)(“H”DesP iff P=F)&¬F”H”) – since “¬(∃>F)” is equivalent to “(F)¬”,¬(H”DesH&(P)(“H”DesP iff P=H)&¬H”H”) – substituting “H” for “F”,

¬((P)(“H”DesP iff P=H)&¬H”H”) – assuming “H” designates H,

H”H” – assuming (P)(“H”DesP iff P=H).

To get the contradiction

H”H” iff ¬H”H”,

therefore, one has to be assured that there is one and only one property which “H” designates. And Copi gives no proof of this.

The Liar Paradox is a further self-referential, semantical paradox, perhaps the major one to come down from antiquity. And one may very well ask, with respect to

What I am now saying is false,

for instance, whether this has any sense, or involves a substantive issue, as Mackie would have it (see also Parsons 1984). But there is a well known further paradox which seems to block this dismissal. For if we allow, as well as “true” and “false” also “meaningless,” then it might well seem that The Strengthened Liar arises, which, in this case, could be expressed

What I am now saying is false, or meaningless.

If I am saying nothing meaningful here, then seemingly what I say is true, which seems to imply that it does have meaning, after all.

Let us, therefore, look at some other notable ways of trying to escape even the Unstrengthened Liar. The Unstrengthened Liar comes in a whole host of variations, for instance:

This very sentence is false,

Some sentence in this book is false,

if that sentence is the only sentence in a book, say in its preface. It also arises with the following pair of sentences taken together:

The following sentence is false,The previous sentence is true;

and in a case of Buridan’s,

What Plato is saying is false,What Socrates is saying is true,

if Socrates says the first, while Plato says the second. There are many other variations, some of which we shall look at later.

The semantical concepts in these paradoxes are truth and falsity, and the first major contribution to our understanding of these, in the twentieth century, was by Tarski. Tarski took truth and falsity to be predicates of sentences, and discussed at length the following example of his famous “T-scheme”:

“snow is white” is true if and only if snow is white.

He believed that

Ts iff p,

holds, quite generally, if “s” is some phrase naming, or referring, to the sentence “p” — for instance, as above, that same sentence in quotation marks, or a number in some system of numbering, which was the way Gödel handled such matters. Tarski’s analysis of truth involved denying that there could be “semantic closure” that is the presence in a language of the semantic concepts relating to expressions in that language (Tarski 1956, p402):

The main source of the difficulties met with seems to lie in the following: it has not always been kept in mind that the semantical concepts have a relative character, that they must always be related to a particular language. People have not been aware that the language about which we speak need by no means coincide with the language in which we speak. They have carried out the semantics of a language in that language itself and, generally speaking, they have proceeded as though there was only one language in the world. The analysis of the antinomies mentioned shows, on the contrary, that the semantical concepts simply have no place in the language to which they relate, that the language which contains its own semantics, and within which the usual laws of logic hold, must inevitably be inconsistent.

This conclusion, which requires that any consistent language be incomplete, Tarski derived directly by considering The Liar, since “This is false” seems to provide a self-referential “s” for which

s = “¬Ts”,

hence, substituting in the following example of the T-scheme

T”¬Ts” iff ¬Ts,

we get

Ts iff ¬Ts.

To block this conclusion Tarski held that the self-reference seemingly available in the identity

s = “¬Ts”

was just not consistently available, and specifically that, if one used the sentence “this is false” then the referent of “this” should not be that very sentence itself – on pain of the evident contradiction. Using “this is false” coherently meant speaking about an object language, but in another, higher, language – the meta-language. Of course the semantical concepts applicable in this meta-language likewise could not be sensibly defined within it, so generally there was supposed to be a whole hierarchy of languages.

It seems difficult to apply this kind of stratification of languages to the way we ordinarily speak, however. Indeed, to assert that truth can attach to indexical sentences, like “What I am now saying is false,” would seem to be flying in the face of a very clear truth (Kneale 1972, p234f). Consider, further, this variation of the Plato-Socrates case above (compare Haack 1978, p144), where Jones says

All of Nixon’s utterances about Watergate are false,

and Nixon says

All of Jones’ utterances about Watergate are true.

If, following Tarski, we were to try to assign levels of language to this pair of utterances, then how could we do it? It would seem that Jones’ utterance would have to be in a language higher, in Tarski’s hierarchy, than any of Nixon’s; yet, contrariwise, Nixon’s would have to be higher than any of Jones’.

Martin has produced a typology of solutions to the Liar which locates Tarski’s way out as one amongst four possible, general diagnoses (Martin 1984, p4). The two principles which Martin takes to categorise the Liar we have just seen, namely

(S) There is a sentence which says of itself only that it is not true,

and

(T) Any sentence is true if and only if what it says is the case.

Tarski, in these terms, took claim (S) to be incorrect. But one also might claim that (T) is incorrect, maybe because there are sentences without a truth value, being meaningless, or lacking in content in some other way, as is held by the theorists mentioned before. A third general diagnosis claims that both (S) and (T) are correct, and indeed incompatible, but proceeds to some “rational reconstruction” of them so that the incompatibility is removed. Fourthly it is possible to argue that (S) and (T) are correct, but really compatible. Martin sees this happening as a result of some possible ambiguity in the terms used in the two principles.

We can isolate a further, fifth option, although Martin does not consider it. That option is to hold that both (S) and (T) are incorrect, as is done by the tradition which holds that it is not sentences which are true or false. One cannot say, for instance, that the sentence “that is white” is true, in itself, since what is spoken of might vary from one utterance of the sentence to another. Following the second world war, because of this sort of thing, it became more common to think of semantical notions as attached not to sentences and words, but to what such sentences and words mean (Kneale and Kneale 1962, p601f). On this understanding it is not specifically the sentence “that is white” but what is expressed by this sentence, that is the statement or proposition made by it, which may be true. But it was shown by Thomason, following work by Montague, that the same sorts of problems can be generated even in this case. We can create self-referential paradoxes to do with statements and propositions which again cannot be obviously escaped (Thomason 1977, 1980, 1986). And the problems are not just confined to the semantics of truth and falsity, but also arise in just the same way with more general semantical notions like knowledge, belief, and provability. In recent years, the much larger extent of the problems to do with self-reference has, in this way, become increasingly apparent.

Asher and Kamp sum up (Asher and Kamp 1989, p87):

Thomason argues that the results of Montague (1963) apply not only to theories in which attitudinal concepts, such as knowledge and belief, are treated as predicates of sentences, but also to “representational” theories of the attitudes, which analyse these concepts as relations to, or operations on (mental) representations. Such representational treatments of the attitudes have found many advocates; and it is probably true that some of their proponents have not been sufficiently alert to the pitfalls of self-reference even after those had been so clearly exposed in Montague (1963)… To such happy-go-lucky representationalists, Thomason (1980) is a stern warning of the obstacles that a precise elaboration of their proposals would encounter.

Thomason mentions specifically Fodor’s “Language of Thought” in his work; Asher and Kamp themselves show that modes of argument similar to Thomason’s can be used even to show that Montague’s Intensional Semantics has the same problems. Asher and Kamp go on to explain the general method which achieves these results (Asher and Kamp 1989, p87):

Thomason’s argument is, at least on the face of it, straightforward. He reasons as follows: Suppose that a certain attitude, say belief, is treated as a property of “proposition-like” objects – let us call them “representations” – which are built up from atomic constituents in much the way that sentences are. Then, with enough arithmetic at our disposal, we can associate a Gödel number with each such object and we can mimic the relevant structural properties of and relations between such objects by explicitly defined arithmetical predicates of their Gödel numbers. This Gödelisation of representations can then be exploited to derive a contradiction in ways familiar from the work of Gödel, Tarski and Montague.

The only ray of hope Asher and Kamp can offer is (Asher and Kamp 1989, p94): “Only the familiar systems of epistemic and doxastic logic, in which knowledge and belief are treated as sentential operators, and which do not treat propositions as objects of reference and quantification, seem solidly protected from this difficulty.” But see on these, for instance, Mackie 1973, p276f, although also Slater 1986.

Gödel’s famous theorems in this area are, of course, concerned with the notion of provability, and they show that if this notion is taken as a predicate of certain formulas, then in any standard formal system which has enough arithmetic to handle the Gödel numbers used to identify the formulas in the system, certain statements can be constructed which are true, but are not provable in the system, if it is consistent. What is also true, and even provable in such a system is that, if it is consistent then (a) a certain specific self-referential formula is not provable in the system, and (b) the consistency of the system is not provable in the system. This means the consistency of the system cannot be proved in the system unless it is inconsistent, and it is commonly believed that the appropriate systems are consistent. But if they are consistent then this result shows they are incomplete, that is there are truths which they cannot prove.

The paradoxical thing about Gödel’s Theorems is that they seem to show that there are things we can ourselves prove, in the natural language we use to talk about formal systems, but which a formal system of proof cannot prove. And that fact has been fed into the very large debate about our differences from, even superiority over mechanisms (see e.g. Penrose 1989). But if we consider the way many people would argue about, for instance,

this very sentence is unprovable,

then our abilities as humans might not seem to be too great. For many people would argue:

If that sentence is provable then it is true, since provability entails truth; but that makes it unprovable, which is a contradiction. Hence it must be unprovable. But by this process we seem to have proved that it is unprovable – another contradiction!

So, unless we can extricate ourselves from this impasse, as well as the many others we have looked at, we would not seem to be too bright. Or does this sort of argument show that there is, indeed, no escape? Some people, of course, might want to follow Tarski, and run from “natural language” in the face of these conclusions. For Gödel had no reason to conclude, from his theorems, that the formal systems he was concerned with were inconsistent. However, his formal arguments differ crucially from that just given, since there is no proof within his systems that “provability” entails “truth.” There is no doubt that what we have been dealing with are real paradoxes!

The intractability of the impasse here, and the failure of many great minds to make headway with it, has lead some theorists to believe that indeed there is no escape. Notable amongst these is Priest (compare Priest 1979), who believes we must now learn to accept that some contradictions can be true, and adjust our logic accordingly. This is very much in line with the expectation we initially noted Quine had, that maybe “some tacit and trusted pattern of reasoning must be made explicit and henceforward be avoided or revised.” (Quine 1966, p7) The particular law which “paraconsistent” logicians mainly doubt is “ex impossibile quodlibet”, that is “from an impossibility anything follows,” or

(p&¬p) ⊢ q.

It is thought that, if this traditional rule were removed from logic then, at least, any true contradictions we find, e.g. anything of the form “p&¬p” which we deduce from some paradox of self-reference, will not have the wholesale repercussions that it otherwise would have in traditional logic. Objectors to paraconsistency might say that the premise of this rule could not arise, so its “explosive” repercussions would never eventuate. But there is the broader, philosophical question, as well, about whether a switch to a different logic does not just change the subject, leaving the original problems unattacked. That depends on how one views “deviant logics.” There are reasons to believe that deviant logics are not rivals of traditional logic, but merely supplementary to, or extensions of it (Haack, 1974, Pt 1, Ch1). For if one drops the above rule then hasn’t one merely produced a new kind of negation? Are “p” and “¬p” still contradictory, if they can, somehow, both be true? And if “p” and “¬p” are not contradictory, then what is contradictory to “p”, and couldn’t we formulate the previous paradoxes in terms of it? It seems we may have just turned our backs on the real difficulty.

5. A Contemporary Twist

There have been developments, in the last few years, which have shown that the previous emphasis on paradoxes involving self-reference was to some extent misleading. For a family of paradoxes, with similar levels of intractability, have been discovered, which are not reflexive in this way.

It was mentioned before that a form of the Liar paradox could be derived in connection with the pair of statements

What Plato is saying is false,

What Socrates is saying is true,

when Socrates says the former, and Plato the latter. For, if what Socrates is saying is true, then, according to the former, what Plato is saying is false, but then, according to the latter, what Socrates is saying is false. On the other hand, if what Socrates is saying is false then, according to the former, what Plato is saying is true, and then, according to the latter, what Socrates is saying is true. Such a paradox is called a “liar chain”; they can be of any length; and with them we are already out of the really strict “self-reference” family, although, by passing along through the chain what Socrates is saying, it will eventually come back to reflect on itself.

It seems, however, that, if one creates what might be called “infinite chains” then there is not even this attenuated form of self-reference (though see Beall, 2001). Yablo asked us to consider an infinite sequence of sentences of which the following is representative (Yablo 1993):

(S_i) For all k>i, S_k is untrue.

Sorensen’s “Queue Paradox” is similar, and can be obtained by replacing “all” by “some” here, and considering the series of thoughts of some students in an infinite queue (Sorensen 1998). Suppose that, in Yablo’s case, S_n is true for some n. Then S_n+1 is false, and all subsequent statements; but the latter fact makes S_n+1 true; giving a contradiction. Hence for no n is S_n true. But that means that S₁ is true, S₂ is true, etc; in fact it means every statement is true, which is another contradiction. In Sorensen’s case, if some student thinks “some of the students behind me are now thinking an untruth” then this cannot be false, since then all the students behind her are thinking the truth – although that means that some student behind her is speaking an untruth, a contradiction. So no student is thinking an untruth. But if some student is consequently thinking a truth, then some student behind them is thinking an untruth, which we know to be impossible. Indeed every supposition seems impossible, and we are in the characteristic impasse.

Gaifman has worked up a way of dealing with such more complex paradoxes of the Liar sort, which can end up denying the sentences in such loops, chains, and infinite sequences have any truth value whatever. Using “GAP” for “recognised failure to assign a standard truth value” Gaifman formulates what he calls the “closed loop rule” (Gaifman 1992, pp225, 230):

If, in the course of applying the evaluation procedure, a closed unevaluated loop forms and none of its members can be assigned a standard value by any of the rules, then all of its members are assigned GAP in a single evaluation step.

Goldstein has formulated a comparable process, which he thinks improves upon Gaifman in certain details, and which ends up labelling certain sentences “FA”, meaning that the sentence has made a “failed attempt” at making a statement (Goldstein 2000, p57). But the major question with such approaches, as before, is how they deal with The Strengthened Liar. Surely there remain major problems with

This sentence is false, or has a GAP,

and

This sentence makes a false statement, or is a FA.

6. References and Further Reading

Asher, N. and Kamp, H. 1986, “The Knower’s Paradox and Representational Theories of Attitudes,” in J. Halpern (ed.) Theoretical Aspects of Reasoning about Knowledge, San Mateo CA, Morgan Kaufmann.
Asher, N. and Kamp, H. 1989, “Self-Reference, Attitudes and Paradox” in G. Chierchia, B.H. Partee, and R. Turner (eds.) Properties, Types and Meaning 1.
Beall, J.C., 2001, “Is Yablo’s Paradox Non-Circular?,” Analysis 61.3.
Copi, I.M., 1973, Symbolic Logic 4th ed. Macmillan, New York.
Gaifman, H. 1992, “Pointers to Truth,” The Journal of Philosophy, 89, 223-61.
Goldstein, L. 2000, “A Unified Solution to Some Paradoxes,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 100, pp53-74.
Grattan-Guinness, I. (ed.) 1980, From the Calculus to Set Theory, 1630-1910, Duckworth, London.
Haack, S. 1974, Deviant Logic, C.U.P., Cambridge.
Haack, S. 1978, Philosophy of Logics, C.U.P., Cambridge.
Hallett, M. 1984, Cantorian Set Theory and Limitation of Size, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Keefe, R. 2001, Theories of Vagueness, C.U.P. Cambridge.
Kneale, W. 1972, “Propositions and Truth in Natural Languages,” Mind, 81, pp225-243.
Kneale, W. and Kneale M. 1962, The Development of Logic, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Lavine, S. 1994, Understanding the Infinite, Harvard University Press, Cambridge MA.
Linsky, L. 1967, Referring, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London.
Mackie, J.L. 1973, Truth, Probability and Paradox, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Martin, R.L. (ed.) 1984, Recent Essays on Truth and the Liar Paradox, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Martin-Löf, P. 1970, Notes on Constructive Mathematics, Almqvist and Wiksell, Stockholm.
Montague, R. 1963, “Syntactic Treatments of Modality, with Corollaries on Reflection Principles and Finite Axiomatisability,” Acta Philosophica Fennica, 16, pp153-167.
Owen, G.E.L. 1957-8, “Zeno and the Mathematicians,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 58, 199-222.
Parsons, C. 1984, “The Liar Paradox” in R.L.Martin (ed.) Recent Essays on Truth and the Liar Paradox, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Penrose, R. 1989, The Emperor’s New Mind, O.U.P., Oxford.
Priest, G.G. 1979, “The Logic of Paradox,” Journal of Philosophical Logic, 8, pp219-241.
Priest, G.G. 1994, “The Structure of the Paradoxes of Self-Reference,” Mind, 103, pp25- 34.
Quine, W.V.O. 1966, The Ways of Paradox, Random House, New York.
Ryle, G. 1950-1, “Heterologicality,” Analysis, 11, pp61-69.
Sainsbury, M. 1995, Paradoxes, 2nd ed., C.U.P. Cambridge.
Salmon, W.C. (ed.) 1970, Zeno’s Paradoxes, Bobbs-Merrill, Indianapolis.
Scott, T.K. 1966, John Buridan: Sophisms on Meaning and Truth, Appleton-Century- Crofts, New York.
Slater, B.H. 1986, “Prior’s Analytic,” Analysis, 46, pp76-81.
Sorensen, R. 1998, “Yablo’s Paradox and Kindred Infinite Liars,” Mind, 107, 137-55.
Suppes, P. 1972, Axiomatic Set Theory, Dover, New York.
Tarski, A. 1956, Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics: Papers from 1923 to 1938, trans. J.H. Woodger, O.U.P. Oxford.
Thomason, R. 1977, “Indirect Discourse is not Quotational,” The Monist, 60, pp340-354.
Thomason, R. 1980, “A Note on Syntactical Treatments of Modality,” Synthese, 44, pp391-395
Thomason, R. 1986, “Paradoxes and Semantic Representation,” in J.Halpern (ed.) Theoretical Aspects of Reasoning about Knowledge, San Mateo CA, Morgan Kaufmann.
Williamson, T. 1994, Vagueness, London, Routledge.
Yablo, S. 1993, “Paradox without Self-Reference,” Analysis, 53, 251-52.

For more discussion of the logical paradoxes, see the following articles within this encyclopedia:

Author Information

Barry Hartley Slater
Email: slaterbh@cyllene.uwa.edu.au
University of Western Australia
Australia

Pacifism

Pacifism is the theory that peaceful rather than violent or belligerent relations should govern human intercourse and that arbitration, surrender, or migration should be used to resolve disputes. Pacifism is as much an element of Western thinking as is the notion of Just War Theory, the argument that the state may legitimately or morally bear arms. While most people accept the necessity of war, conscientious objectors (or martyrs in much of European history) have often been accorded a special recognition for their moral bravery in refusing to take up arms.

The philosophical study of pacifism requires examining a variety of aspects of the broad proposal, as well as an investigation as to its consequences. Pacifism relates to war as well as to domestic injustices and repressive policies. It can be studied in terms of its coherence as a deontological, or intrinsic, value as well as in terms of the beneficial effects it seeks. Examination of the broad theory draws our attention to a vast range of possible ethical meanings and issues that the committed pacifist or critic must consider. The doctrine of absolute pacifism is first dealt with, before turning to an examination of the more flexible doctrines of pacifism and conditional pacifism.

General Pacifism
The Ethics of Pacifism
Conclusion

1. General Pacifism

The best place to begin an analysis of pacifism is with the absolutist argument that all forms of violence, war, and/or killing are unconditionally wrong. The proposed ideal is that social intercourse should be completely non-violent and peaceful, and conflicts which may arise should be dealt with through arbitration and compromise rather than with recourse to violent means. Absolutist pacifism asserts that peace is intrinsically a good to be upheld either as a duty or on the consequentialist grounds that it is more conducive to human welfare than any use of violence or force.

The ethical evaluation of these two positions, the deontological and the consequentialist, provides the traditional framework in which ethicists examine pacifism. But what becomes an immediate concern is the kind of pacifism that is intended. Pacifism for many means an anti-war stance, but pacifism can also be construed as a broader theory incorporating doctrines of non-violence, passive resistance, and moral purity. Although the emphasis on pacifism as an anti-war doctrine is the focus of this article, the other nuances of the theory need to be noted.

The first issue to deal with is that while pacifism emphasizes the role that peace should play, there are three general aspects derived from the nature of peaceful relations. First, there is the absolute prohibition of war; second, the absolute prohibition of violence (or force); and third, the absolute prohibition of killing. The three areas of ethical investigation certainly overlap, and most pacifists hold an ethic of non-violence, which underpins both their disdain of killing and of war. Others, however, deny any moral validity to war but accept the use of force or violence (and even killing) under criteria established by the rule of law; some seek a purely non-violent way of life, where as other pacifists are solely nuclear pacifists in that they accept the use of conventional war but not nuclear war.

Before moving onto an ethical analysis of pacifism, the concepts of killing, violence, force, and innocents are reviewed.

a. Killing

Morally, the topic of killing is intricate and complex, deserving a separate consideration, however, for the purposes of examining the various possible readings of pacifism, it can be generally asserted that pacifists cannot condone killing. Their beliefs emphasize the sanctity of human life, according it a special moral status that necessitates strong justifications for the injuring, harming, restraining, or killing of another. Absolute pacifists deny that there can be any justification for killing. The Mosaic command, thou shalt not kill resounds throughout much Western culture and philosophy and is the starting point for absolutist prohibitions on the killing of people in the Western philosophical tradition.

Ethically, the problem of killing divides between passive and active killing as well as intentional, unintentional, and foreseeable variations. The pacifist needs to relate his general moral outlook to these particular areas. For example, would the pacifist prohibit all forms of killing, including mercy killings and killings in self-defense? Is it any form of killing that the pacifist prohibits, or only those of innocents lives, or those in foreign territories? Or does the pacifist draw a distinction between killing and murder, with the implication that killing could be morally acceptable (e.g., abortion, euthanasia, capital punishment), whereas the intentional killing of an innocent be absolutely immoral? Even so, a pacifist could consistently claim that he would prefer to die rather than raise his fist to protect himself. Kahlil Gibran argues: “If my survival caused another to perish, then death would be sweeter and more beloved.” (The Voice of the Poet). In such ethics, the evil of killing in self-defense outweighs the moral value of the victim s own life and the moral purity of the pacifist is to be upheld as the governing ethic. But self-immolation and especially sacrifice are ultimately illogical, for if all were to sacrifice themselves in the quest for moral purity, none would be left to continue the human race. However, the pursuit of purity can also be criticized for being other-worldly, unrealistic, and utopian, and in turn purification policies have also often become crusades against sinners and heretics (cf. Barrington Moore s Moral Purity and Persecution in History), which even the Buddhist religion is not averse to accepting. The pacifist who seeks, regardless of the actions of others, moral purity often requires subsidizing or free rides on the moral impurity of others. The pacifist may reply that it is the duty of only a select élite to be morally pure (a priestly class) or that only a select élite are capable of such purity and that they must so act to become semi-divine agents on earth. The reply is cogent, however it admits a moral division in humanity, namely that some are morally better than others and that others live to serve the priests, an argument that moral egalitarians (“each to count for one and no more than one” Bentham) would reject.

While a few pacifists (especially in the religious vein) may accept the absolute ideal of peace, most have to justify their enjoyment of peace at the expense of others who actively defend the lives of their fellow citizens as well as those of the pacifists. The dilemma is captured well in a quotation from Clifford Simmons in Paskins and Dockrill s Ethics of War.

“I could not stand aside from the experiences of others…I still believed that the position of the pacifist was ultimately right but I was beginning to realize that, at the same time, I could not stand aside from the struggle which was engulfing my contemporaries.” (p.182)

There are two solutions for the pacifist at this junction. Firstly, to prohibit any form of self-preservation that requires harming another, even if he is an aggressor, in the belief that one s life is less morally valuable than one s pure death. The criticism is that this rewards aggression, for “evil will always flourish when good men do nothing” (Edmund Burke), to which the pacifist may reply that the rewards for moral purity are not to be found in this life but in the after-life, a reply that is not attractive to those who do not believe in life after death. The second solution is to divide humanity into those who may seek and attain moral purity and those who cannot or should not. This avoids any need to resort to postmortem tales of heavenly rewards, but then raises a host of political and ethical questions as to the membership of the pure élite.

b. The Nature of Violence

The next philosophical problem that pacifism has to deal with is what is meant by violence. The adjective violent applies to many situations that the nominal pacifist would not necessarily oppose, from its uses to describe agitated or passionate behavior to morally legitimately violent actions against the self or another person. For example, the martial and pugnacious sports involve a violence that the pacifist could accept, although many would decry such institutions as being part of the culture of violence that pervades aggressive nations (and hence are deemed potential causal factors in war) and which ought to be banned or severely limited. Yet the violence meted out on, say a person s body in surgery is not something that most pacifists would accept deserving abolition.

Pacifists may also accept that a violent passion or argument is not something that should be prohibited or morally censured, although there are thinkers here, say, in the Chinese Confucian philosophy that aspire to the calmer control of the mind/spirit over the emotions, and any violent reaction (hysterical laughter, grief, etc.) or reversion to a violent manner disrupts the inner calm a man should seek, which in turn forms the basis of a peaceful community. Similarly, those who claim that reason is man s most important faculty, and that it can and should rule the body and its conflicting emotions, assert that violent behavior or action against another is inimical to the life of a rational being and should be avoided absolutely.

c. The Use of Force

Connected to issues of violence is the use of force against another person which a pacifist must consider. The use of force (again a complex area of study in itself) can take many forms including legal restraint as well as bodily restraint. Effectively both seek to confine the movement of the individual and pacifists may or may not reject the use of force in civil society. The use of force need not be violent, or do physical damage, but does imply some infringement on the free activity of an agent. The philosophical discussion revolves around the justification of that infringement, whether, for example, it can be legitimate or justifiable in any situation. Some, on the anarchist wing, can claim that any use of force is an abrogation of morality, whereas most pacifists accept the need to restrain dangerous individuals from harming others. A question that may be put to such thinkers is why should there be a distinction between protecting people from dangerous civilians and protecting from dangerous nations. In other words, the pacifist has to consider the moral nature of political sovereignty and, if necessary, justify the reason why the use of force is permitted domestically but not internationally for similar issues.

Generally, those that oppose the use of force or violence in society deplore the use of physical means to intervene in another person s behavior, although some are willing to expand the concept of force or violence to include emotional abuse, cultural prejudices, mental games that is, forms of psychological warfare and propaganda designed to undermine the dignity of the individual.

d. Innocents

Who is the target of any war, violence, force, or restraint also has to be considered by the pacifist. Few would admit that a dangerous person should not be restrained in some form or other, and most pacifists would accept injuring or even killing a dangerous criminal if the circumstances admit it, although the argument for retaining a moral purity can be deployed here, leaving the pacifist to justify permitting aggression to flourish.

In this case, the pacifist has to evaluate the moral nature of the particular threat against duties towards others and their right to peace. Deontological pacifists, those who assert that peaceful interaction is a duty to be supported, must weigh their pacifism against the violation of that peace by criminals or dangerous persons. Some pacifists here resort to defining innocents as people deserving their dignity and peace and whose lives ought to be protected against violent offenders. Violence and the use of force by domestic authorities may be thus permitted by pacifists, who reject war or interventions across borders, but they would emphasize that any infringement should be reasonable and be legitimate and should avoid any unnecessary violence. Once an interventionist war is morally permitted the pacifist becomes at least pacificist (see below).

The most intricate difficulty facing the general pacifist is the link between personal pacifism and international pacifism, which is not very clear-cut in most writings. Some pacifists, as we have seen, may admit the use of internal aggression to sustain law and order but be set against the use of aggression for resolving international disputes. Unlike domestic issues, they can argue, international affairs is subject to no overriding supreme authority that can be turned to for conflict resolution, and here the pacifist would argue that war should never be employed as a means for resolving disputes between morally or politically equal corporate entities. However, the question can be raised as to why the use of force is morally legitimate within a nation s borders (to restrain criminals) but not so beyond them (to restrain international criminals), especially if the case involves halting the illegitimate use of aggression by one party against innocents.

2. The Ethics of Pacifism

As noted above, pacifist ethics can be described from two main viewpoints. Firstly, the deontological position which decrees that moral agents have an absolute duty to avoid aggressing or waging war against others. Secondly, the consequentialist position which asserts that no good ever comes from aggressive actions or war and it is thereby prohibited, not because it is an evil in itself, but because it always leads to a worse off position for the majority. This section investigates firstly the absolutist doctrine, then conditional pacifism from both perspectives.

a. Absolute Pacifism

ii. Deontological Pacifism

Held as a duty, it is incumbent on the pacifist never to aggress, use force, or support or engage in war against another. Duties are moral actions that are required or demanded in all pertinent circumstances.

The first problem for deontological pacifism is the potential collision of duties. What if force is to be used to halt an aggressor who endangers the pacifist s life, or the life of an innocent? Regarding the pacifist s own life, it can be argued that he or she possesses no right of self-defense (and must “turn the other cheek”), although this is typically the position of those who place not much value on living this life in favor of living a life in the realms beyond. Among such adherents are religious pacifists. Another example: does the duty to respect others outweigh the duty to respect oneself? The aggressor obviously transcends any duty of respect he should have towards his victim but does that warrant the forfeiture of his life? Those pacifists who admit the right to defend the self against a threat can admit the use of restraining or disabling force and even, if the threat is deadly, the right to kill an assailant. Deontological pacifists can claim that others rights to life are of a higher order duty than the duty to intervene to save oneself. But that hinges upon a moral evaluation of the self compared to others, and it is not clear why others should accord a higher moral evaluation: for after all the self is in turn one amongst many others from a different subject s point of view.

If the pacifist argues that his life is his own to lay down in the face of aggression (as a moral principle, as a moral example, as an example of martyrdom, etc), the problem intensifies when the life of another is threatened, whom the pacifist is in a position to assist, and who, as a living subject, may prefer life over death.

The pacifist who claims that he has no duty to intervene in saving others affairs treads a precarious moral path here; the immediate retort is why should the moral life of the pacifist be morally more important than the life of the threatened innocent? For the sake of his own beliefs, could the pacifist consistently ignore the violence meted upon others? Yes, from two possible perspectives. The first is that the ideal of pacifism retains a supremacy over all other ideals and is not to be compromised. The second is that the life of the pacifist is morally superior to the life of the threatened innocent, even if that innocent happens to be a fellow absolute pacifist.

Deontologists argue that certain kinds of moral actions are good in themselves, hence deontological pacifists claim peace to be a duty to be categorically upheld; however, other moralists argue for pacifism on the basis of its beneficial consequences rather than any intrinsic notion of the good these are consequentialist pacifists.

ii. Consequentialist Pacifism

Pacifism can be supported by moral consequentialists who assert that the evils procured by violence, force, or war, far outweigh any of the good that may arise. For example, rule utilitarians claim that if certain inimical consequences flow from particular actions, a blanket prohibition on such actions is morally required, which, in terms of the implications of the argument brings them close to the deontological position of an absolute prohibition of war, etc.

Rule utilitarianism holds that a behavioral code or rule is morally right if the consequences of adopting that rule are more favorable than unfavorable to everyone. Accordingly, rule utilitarian pacifists claim that the avoidance of war (or violence, or force) should be a moral rule since its abrogation would be less beneficial to all. For example, if, on balance, all hitherto wars are perceived as producing effects that none would have wanted prior to the war, then a rule against war should be adopted. The rule outlaws war in the particular and in general, even if a particular war could produce better consequences it should not be accepted on the grounds that it violates a moral rule, and that moral rule claims more favorable consequences for entire world if war is absolutely prohibited.

However, absolute consequentialist principles are exceedingly difficult to sustain, for they are firstly based on a particular reading of history a reading that can emphasize ruinous results over any good that may ultimately have arisen. They are empirical judgements on the past and as such open to not only historical critique but also the logical argument that what was true yesterday may not be true tomorrow (or at least cannot be proven to be so). That is, while past wars were wholly detrimental to the human race as a whole, tomorrow s wars, because of new technology or strategy, or even a new ethic, may not be. Accordingly, the moral rule may in principle change and therefore cannot be held absolutely.

It is possible, for example, to consider that the Second World War (and all the untoward deaths and destruction that it brought) ultimately promoted the greater good of a peaceful Europe and enhanced international co-operation. It is difficult to empirically sustain that nothing good ever came from war , for critics can always point to something good whose value may be suitably expanded to provide an argument; in which case the argument becomes a comparison of goods and their respective moral weightings (20 million deaths versus fifty plus years of European peace for hundreds of millions).

iii. Absuolute Pacifism Summarized

In summary, the absolute pacifist of both ethical persuasions prohibits war regardless of particular circumstances. As a doctrine, the onus in on justifying the pacifist principle against arguments for aggression and war. What, it may be asked, should be the appropriate response to a person who believes that violence is a morally appropriate method to gain values? The absolute pacifist thus has to justify not retaliating or defending himself or others (innocents or not) in the face of aggression. Often the recourse is to non-earthly values such as the Kingdom of Heaven, i.e., death is morally superior to violent resistance, deterrence, or aggression, or to a moral division between peoples, between the superior pacifists and the impure aggressors.

b. Conditional Pacifism

Against the doctrinal absolute prohibition of the use of violence or war, conditional pacifism admits its use under certain circumstances. Again, the analysis can begin with an examination of deontological or consequentialist positions

i. Conditional Deontological Pacifism

Conditional pacifism from the deontological perspective admits that the enactment of duties cannot be considered in isolation, for they may overlap and hence require a conditional acceptance or a moral weighing. For the conditional pacifist, the duty to uphold peace and non-violence may conflict with the duty to save or defend lives against aggression, if the latter duty is accepted. Therefore, in cases of what Walzer calls supreme emergencies (Just and Unjust Wars), the duty to peace may be trumped by alternative ethical requirements.

To take an example from political theory that is an appropriate area of discussion here: a common defense of the use of violence or war is that it is a justifiable or legitimate procedure to defend rights, and rights theories are often supported from a conditional deontological position. The pacifist counters that the argument to violate rights to protect rights is incoherent, for the use of force inherently violates the rights it is supposed to defend or protect. The alleged paradox is resolved, it can be argued, by asserting that rights are things to be upheld and defended, firstly as negative claims requiring an absence of violation, and secondly as positive claims that require freedom to pursue goals. An aggressor violates both elements. A right cannot be a value unless it is defensible, but it does not mean that the rights of aggressors are infringed in defending one s rights, for, as Lockean theorists argue, aggressors lose rights in attacking others. Pacifists can disagree with this and argue that if rights theory is to be coherent, rights ought to be inviolable and inalienable. Hence if they are contingently held they cannot be deemed inviolable rights but conditional privileges , which may accordingly be removed if someone abuses their own rights entitlements by violating those of others.

ii. Conditional Utilitarian Pacifism

For the consequentialist, all moral guides are conditional on the circumstances and protracted outcomes of an action. In the case of conditional pacifism, a utilitarian ascribes to act utilitarianism in which each particular act, war, battle, etc., is examined from the moral perspective of what outcome is likely to produce more favorable results. Accordingly, whilst the pacifist may claim that wars generally do not produce more favorable results, in specific examples they can be acceptable. Such examples may include wars of self-defense, or wars of intervention to protect a people from genocidal campaigns. But the further removed the pacifist gets from the peaceful ideal, the more he or she moves into the just war realm, or the theory called pacificism .

c. Pacificism

Pacificism, defined by Martin Caedel (Thinking about War and Peace, 1987), is a useful term to describe those who prefer peaceful conditions to war but who accept that some wars may be necessary if they advance the cause of peace. In a sense this is a further step away from conditional pacifism which rules out war or the use of force except in very exceptional circumstances. In this case, the political achievements that have generated peace may be defended militarily if necessary for the overriding goal of global peace.

Following Richard Norman (Ethics, Killing, and War, 1995), pacificism falls between pacifism and defencism, where defencism is the theory that accepts all defensive wars and acts of deterrence as just (but which rules out aggressive wars). It implies an interesting justification of war for peace s sake that is not essential to defencism but which also steps beyond the sometimes non-worldly or unrealistic vision of pacifism. Pacificism can reject a defensive war if it undermines the overall concord that may be latent in the international (or national in the case of civil war) situation. This reaches into some intriguing territory, for its remit is vague but also flexible.

On the vague side, pacificism falls back onto similar problems that general consequentialism faces, namely the inability to propose a rule or guiding principle that is not affected by either new events or alternative interpretations of the same event. This, like general consequentialism, provides the theory with flexibility, but where this does become an issue is in the logical extension of the theory to proclaim the war to end all wars as a pacificistic ideal, which logically it does entail.

A defensive war, justified on the traditional grounds of just war theory, may be rejected as causing greater overall international instability, but on the other hand it does not thoroughly rule out an aggressive war of intervention or of imperialism to impose peace, although most pacificists would say that it does, on the grounds that all aggressive wars should be ruled out. But why? If two neighboring nations are about to wage a war that will create greater global instability and the chance is there to contain the momentum with an aggressive policing action, then so long as peace is the ultimate goal, the means become morally acceptable.

Pacificism can be acceptable to many shades of opinion. Very few thinkers assert that war should be waged for its own sake, which poses logical problems of its own for often war is to be waged for glory or for valor or for land or for values. But most thinkers will argue that peace is the most favorable condition for man within which to reside: peace enables enterprise, families, and life in general to flourish. Accordingly, such thinkers will accept that to secure peaceful conditions, war may have to be waged, but that it can only be waged for the sake of peace. We read this in Plato, Aristotle, and the host of philosophers and jurists that they influenced. But if peace is the overriding goal, the means to secure peace can really include anything.

For example, one of the longest recorded reigns of human peace lasted in Egypt between 5000 and 2000 BC, partly as a result of geographical isolation and partly as a result of the strict and unchanging social system that prevailed; the imposition of central control may enforce a long term peace, but it is not a means that all may be willing to accept. A strong central state, as Plato argues for in The Republic, could impose peace by permitting no change or allowing any conditions conducive to change. But, arguably, such an environment leads to the stultification of the mind, and if the individual mind is not free to challenge the present order, to disrupt or create, then society is not in a position to adapt, which ultimately does not augur well for any society once change comes from outsiders or changes in the environment for example.

Imperialism often imposes an international peace that few today would accept, but if peace is secured why should the nature of the political institution be rejected if it works? The Romans provided the pax romana and the British attempted a similar pax britannica, that secured peace amongst hitherto belligerent and restless tribes. Most present thinkers reject imperialism yet some such as Michael Ignatieff do wonder whether its benefits may outweigh the costs (The Warrior s Honor). Empirically, it can be claimed that imperialism is globally more stable and peaceful than tribalism and its larger brother, nationalism, both of which have generated a great portion of the world s wars.

On the other hand, a federation of states, as considered by the Abbé Saint-Pierre in his Perpetual Peace and Immanuel Kant in his more famous work of the same name, proposes that while peace is the ultimate end to be secured, a federation of equal states is the appropriate political vehicle.

Kant argues that peoples will be drawn closer together through commercial ties and nature will prompt them to follow the dictates of reason that encourage the more beneficial peaceful enterprises over mutual animosity. Kant suggests that the process towards perpetual peace the pacifistic goal is inevitable, given the manner in which people deal with one another. Yet the optimism of the Age of Enlightenment was soon demolished by counter-acting principles of thought and politics that emphasized the glories of nationalism, of isolationism, and implicitly or explicitly, the benefits that war can bring.

Peaceful intercourse is easily rejected by those who assert the benefits of the martial values, who claim that a war brings out the best of people and of a society, that wars heighten humanity s perception of itself in the great existentialist quest between life and death, that war relieves the monotony of consumerism and so on.

This highlights one of the most difficult aspects of pacificism, that the goal of peace and of tranquillity may not suffice human nature. The persistent nagging of bellicosity, of adventure, personal and collective glory, whether it derives from something genetic or culturally deeply embedded in most societies, remains an easily revitalized clarion call to war. The culture of peace is often very shallow, taking many generations to produce, and even then can be swiftly eroded with atavistic rhetoric. Often what secures the maintenance of peace are the rule of law and the expansion of commercial ties, as Kant foresaw. But these achievements require, in the case of the rule of law, a determined political acceptance of the law and its impartial application, and in the case of commercial ties, a sphere of individual freedom that permits the growth of mutually beneficial ties that most philosophers who look at the world in terms of what needs to be controlled are unable to accept. The crumbling of the rule of law undermines the potential for any society to exist peacefully, but so too does constant intervention in market processes which connects to the need for the rule of law.

Commercial pacificists, those who see in the expansion of the market order the foundations of future peace, point to the nature of domestic peace as the blueprint for international peace. In the past a war between two English counties was quite an acceptable event (The Wars of the Roses between the houses representing Yorkshire and Lancashire) but today a similar proclamation of war would be absurd. In more recent history, the US was torn in two by the States fighting the Civil War, yet war between them today could not be seriously entertained. What has brought peace to these one-time enemies needs to be understood if peace is to be secured between larger or more independent political units.

The optimism of commercial pacificists is criticized on two grounds. Firstly, it may take a longer time to secure peace than the present generation is willing to permit, and secondly, the beneficial processes of market trading and the rule of law may not be acceptable to the target nation or people. In both cases an imposed order of peace may be preferred on consequentialist reasons, that less harm is done in the long run by enforcing a peace today. However, it can be reasonably countered that the imposition of peace on cultures not prepared to shed centuries of belligerence will not secure peace in the long run; various thinkers here, most notably John Stuart Mill, argue that societies must find their own ways to peace (freedom, self-determination) otherwise they will not appreciate them.

3. Conclusion

The article has provided a very general overview of some of the forms pacifism can take, as well as some of the issues it invokes. The area is philosophically broad and intricate, which the expanse of relevant literature reflects. The ethical positions described in the essay divide between deontological and consequentialist positions, but virtue theory is also highly applicable: what kind of person are you if you wield force or if you do turn the other cheek? Is a peaceful life more or less virtuous compared to a life of violence, and on what grounds? I have touched on the religious moral dimension of pacifism, which typically holds that secular life is of a lower value than the protracted life after death, but justice cannot be done to the variety of theological systems and nuances that produce such an ethic. Justifying pacifism from purely secular premises is a much harder task for any thinker who cannot have recourse to rewards in heaven and it is a challenge that is worth exploring for its own sake by any philosopher interested in war or peace.

Author Information

Alexander Moseley
Email: alexandermoseley@icloud.com
United Kingdom

Russell’s Paradox

russell Russell’s paradox represents either of two interrelated logical antinomies. The most commonly discussed form is a contradiction arising in the logic of sets or classes. Some classes (or sets) seem to be members of themselves, while some do not. The class of all classes is itself a class, and so it seems to be in itself. The null or empty class, however, must not be a member of itself. However, suppose that we can form a class of all classes (or sets) that, like the null class, are not included in themselves. The paradox arises from asking the question of whether this class is in itself. It is if and only if it is not. The other form is a contradiction involving properties. Some properties seem to apply to themselves, while others do not. The property of being a property is itself a property, while the property of being a cat is not itself a cat. Consider the property that something has just in case it is a property (like that of being a cat) that does not apply to itself. Does this property apply to itself? Once again, from either assumption, the opposite follows. The paradox was named after Bertrand Russell (1872-1970), who discovered it in 1901.

History
Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Properties
Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Classes or Sets
References and Further Reading

1. History

Russell’s discovery came while he was working on his Principles of Mathematics. Although Russell discovered the paradox independently, there is some evidence that other mathematicians and set-theorists, including Ernst Zermelo and David Hilbert, had already been aware of the first version of the contradiction prior to Russell’s discovery. Russell, however, was the first to discuss the contradiction at length in his published works, the first to attempt to formulate solutions and the first to appreciate fully its importance. An entire chapter of the Principles was dedicated to discussing the contradiction, and an appendix was dedicated to the theory of types that Russell suggested as a solution.

Russell discovered the contradiction from considering Cantor’s power class theorem: the mathematical result that the number of entities in a certain domain is always smaller than the number of subclasses of those entities. Certainly, there must be at least as many subclasses of entities in the domain as there are entities in the domain given that for each entity, one subclass will be the class containing only that entity. However, Cantor proved that there also cannot be the same number of entities as there are subclasses. If there were the same number, there would have to be a 1-1 function f mapping entities in the domain on to subclasses of entities in the domain. However, this can be proven to be impossible. Some entities in the domain would be mapped by f on to subclasses that contain them, whereas others may not. However, consider the subclass of entities in the domain that are not in the subclasses on to which f maps them. This is itself a subclass of entities of the domain, and thus, f would have to map it on to some particular entity in the domain. The problem is that then the question arises as to whether this entity is in the subclass on to which f maps it. Given the subclass in question, it does just in case it does not. The Russell paradox of classes can in effect be seen as an instance of this line of reasoning, only simplified. Are there more classes or subclasses of classes? It would seem that there would have to be more classes, since all subclasses of classes are themselves classes. But if Cantor’s theorem is correct, there would have to be more subclasses. Russell considered the simple mapping of classes onto themselves, and invoked the Cantorian approach of considering the class of all those entities that are not in the classes onto which they are mapped. Given Russell’s mapping, this becomes the class of all classes not in themselves.

The paradox had profound ramifications for the historical development of class or set theory. It made the notion of a universal class, a class containing all classes, extremely problematic. It also brought into considerable doubt the notion that for every specifiable condition or predicate, one can assume there to exist a class of all and only those things that satisfy that condition. The properties version of the contradiction–a natural extension of the classes or sets version–raised serious doubts about whether one can be committed to objective existence of a property or universal corresponding to every specifiable condition or predicate. Indeed, contradictions and problems were soon found in the work of those logicians, philosophers and mathematicians who made such assumptions. In 1902, Russell discovered that a version the contradiction was expressible in the logical system developed in Volume I of Gottlob Frege’s Grundgesetze der Arithmetik, one of the central works in the late-19th and early-20th century revolution in logic. In Frege’s philosophy, a class is understood as the “extension” or “value-range” of a concept. Concepts are the closest correlates to properties in Frege’s metaphysics. A concept is presumed to exist for every specifiable condition or predicate. Thus, there is a concept of being a class that does not fall under its defining concept. There is also a class defined by this concept, and it falls under its defining concept just in case it does not.

Russell wrote to Frege concerning the contradiction in June of 1902. This began one of the most interesting and discussed correspondences in intellectual history. Frege immediately recognized the disastrous consequences of the paradox. He did note, however, that the properties version of the paradox was solved in his philosophy by his distinction between levels of concepts. For him, concepts are understood as functions from arguments to truth-values. Some concepts, “first-level concepts”, take objects as arguments, some concepts, “second-level concepts” take these functions as arguments, and so on. Thus, a concept can never take itself as argument, and the properties version cannot be formulated. However, classes, or extensions or concepts, were all understood by Frege to be of the same logical type as all other objects. The question does arise, then, for each class whether it falls under its defining concept.

When he received Russell’s first letter, the second volume of Frege’s Grundgesetze was already in the latter stages of the publication process. Frege was forced to quickly prepare an appendix in response to the paradox. Frege considers a number of possible solutions. The conclusion he settles on, however, is to weaken the class abstraction principle in the logical system. In the original system, one could conclude that an object is in a class if and only if the object falls under the concept defining the class. In the revised system, one can conclude only that an object is in a class if and only if the object falls under the concept defining the class and the object is not identical to the class in question. This blocks the class version of the paradox. However, Frege was not entirely happy even with this solution. And this was for good reason. Some years later the revised system was found to lead to a more complicated form of the contradiction. Even before this result was discovered, Frege abandoned it and seems to have concluded that his earlier approach to the logic of classes was simply unworkable, and that logicians would have to make do entirely without commitment to classes or sets.

However, other logicians and mathematicians have proposed other, relatively more successful, alternative solutions. These are discussed below.

2. Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Properties

The Theory of Types. It was noted above that Frege did have an adequate response to the contradiction when formulated as a paradox of properties. Frege’s response was in effect a precursor to what one of the most commonly discussed and articulated proposed solutions to this form of the paradox. This is to insist that properties fall into different types, and that the type of a property is never the same as the entities to which it applies. Thus, the question never even arises as to whether a property applies to itself. A logical language that divides entities into such a hierarchy is said to employ the theory of types. Though hinted at already in Frege, the theory of types was first fully explained and defended by Russell in Appendix B of the Principles. Russell’s theory of types was more comprehensive than Frege’s distinction of levels; it divided not only properties into different logical types, but classes as well. The use of the theory of types to solve the other form of Russell’s paradox is described below.

To be philosophically adequate, the adoption of the theory of types for properties requires developing an account of the nature of properties such that one would be able to explain why they cannot apply to themselves. After all, at first blush, it would seem to make sense to predicate a property of itself. The property of being self-identical would seem to be self-identical. The property of being nice seems to be nice. Similarly, it seems false, not nonsensical, to say that the property of being a cat is a cat. However, different thinkers explain the justification for the type-division in different ways. Russell even gave different explanations at different parts of his career. For his part, the justification for Frege’s division of different levels of concepts derived from his theory of the unsaturatedness of concepts. Concepts, as functions, are essentially incomplete. They require an argument in order to yield a value. One cannot simply predicate one concept of a concept of the same type, because the argument concept still requires its own argument. For example, while it is possible to take the square root of the square root of some number, one cannot simply apply the function square root to the function square root and arrive at a value.

Conservatism about Properties. Another possible solution to the paradox of properties would involve denying that a property exists corresponding to any specifiable conditions or well-formed predicate. Of course, if one eschews metaphysical commitment to properties as objective and independent entities altogether, that is, if one adopts nominalism, then the paradoxical question is avoided entirely. However, one does not need to be quite so extreme in order to solve the antinomy. The higher-order logical systems developed by Frege and Russell contained what is called the comprehension principle, the principle that for every open formula, no matter how complex, there exists as entity a property or concept exemplified by all and only those things that satisfy the formula. In effect, they were committed to attributes or properties for any conceivable set of conditions or predicates, no matter how complex. However, one could instead adopt a more austere metaphysics of properties, only granting objective existence to simple properties, perhaps including redness, solidity and goodness, etc. One might even allow that such properties can possibly apply to themselves, e.g. that goodness is good. However, on this approach one would deny the same status to complex attributes, e.g. the so-called “properties” as having-seventeen-heads, being-a-cheese-made-England, having-been-written-underwater, etc. It is simply not the case that any specifiable condition corresponds to a property, understood as an independently existing entity that has properties of its own. Thus, one might deny that there is a simple property being-a-property-that-does-not-apply-to-itself. If so, one can avoid the paradox simply by adopting a more conservative metaphysics of properties.

3. Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Classes or Sets

It was mentioned above that late in his life, Frege gave up entirely on the feasibility of the logic of classes or sets. This is of course one ready solution to the antinomy in the class or set form: simply deny the existence of such entities altogether. Short of this, however, the following solutions have enjoyed the greatest popularity:

The Theory of Types for Classes: It was mentioned earlier that Russell advocated a more comprehensive theory of types than Frege’s distinction of levels, one that divided not only properties or concepts into various types, but classes as well. Russell divided classes into classes of individuals, classes of classes of individuals, and so on. Classes were not taken to be individuals, and classes of classes of individuals were not taken to be classes of individuals. A class is never of the right type to have itself as member. Therefore, there is no such thing as the class of all classes that are not members of themselves, because for any class, the question of whether it is in itself is a violation of type. Once again, here the challenge is to explain the metaphysics of classes or sets in order to explain the philosophical grounds of the type-division.

Stratification: In 1937, W. V. Quine suggested an alternative solution in some ways similar to type-theory. His suggestion was rather than actually divide entities into individuals, classes of individuals, etc., such that the proposition that some class is in itself is always ill-formed or nonsensical, we can instead put certain restrictions on what classes are supposed to exist. Classes are only supposed to exist if their defining conditions are so as to not involve what would, in type theory, be a violation of types. Thus, for Quine, while “x is not a member of x” is a meaningful assertion, we do not suppose there to exist a class of all entities x that satisfy this statement. In Quine’s system, a class is only supposed to exist for some open formula A if and only if the formula A is stratified, that is, if there is some assignment of natural numbers to the variables in A such that for each occurrence of the class membership sign, the variable preceding the membership sign is given an assignment one lower than the variable following it. This blocks Russell’s paradox, because the formula used to define the problematic class has the same variable both before and after the membership sign, obviously making it unstratified. However, it has yet to be determined whether or not the resulting system, which Quine called “New Foundations for Mathematical Logic” or NF for short, is consistent or inconsistent.

Aussonderung: A quite different approach is taken in Zermelo-Fraenkel (ZF) set theory. Here too, a restriction is placed on what sets are supposed to exist. Rather than taking the “top-down” approach of Russell and Frege, who originally believed that for any concept, property or condition, one can suppose there to exist a class of all those things in existence with that property or satisfying that condition, in ZF set theory, one begins from the “bottom up”. One begins with individual entities, and the empty set, and puts such entities together to form sets. Thus, unlike the early systems of Russell and Frege, ZF is not committed to a universal set, a set including all entities or even all sets. ZF puts tight restrictions on what sets exist. Only those sets that are explicitly postulated to exist, or which can be put together from such sets by means of iterative processes, etc., can be concluded to exist. Then, rather than having a naive class abstraction principle that states that an entity is in a certain class if and only if it meets its defining condition, ZF has a principle of separation, selection, or as in the original German, “Aussonderung“. Rather than supposing there to exist a set of all entities that meet some condition simpliciter, for each set already known to exist, Aussonderung tells us that there is a subset of that set of all those entities in the original set that satisfy the condition. The class abstraction principle then becomes: if set A exists, then for all entities x in A, x is in the subset of A that satisfies condition C if and only if x satisfies condition C. This approach solves Russell’s paradox, because we cannot simply assume that there is a set of all sets that are not members of themselves. Given a set of sets, we can separate or divide it into those sets within it that are in themselves and those that are not, but since there is no universal set, we are not committed to the set of all such sets. Without the supposition of Russell’s problematic class, the contradiction cannot be proven.

There have been subsequent expansions or modifications made on all these solutions, such as the ramified type-theory of Principia Mathematica, Quine’s later expanded system of his Mathematical Logic, and the later developments in set-theory made by Bernays, Gödel and von Neumann. The question of what is the correct solution to Russell’s paradox is still a matter of debate.

See also the Russell-Myhill Paradox article in this encyclopedia.

4. References and Further Reading

Coffa, Alberto. “The Humble Origins of Russell’s Paradox.” Russell nos. 33-4 (1979): 31-7.
Frege, Gottlob. The Basic Laws of Arithmetic: Exposition of the System. Edited and translated by Montgomery Furth. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1964.
Frege, Gottlob. Correspondence with Russell. In Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence. Translated by Hans Kaal. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1980.
Geach, Peter T. “On Frege’s Way Out.” Mind 65 (1956): 408-9.
Grattan-Guinness, Ivor. “How Bertrand Russell Discovered His Paradox.” Historica Mathematica 5 (1978): 127-37.
Hatcher, William S. Logical Foundations of Mathematics. New York: Pergamon Press, 1982.
Quine, W. V. O. “New Foundations for Mathematical Logic.” In From a Logical Point of View. 2d rev. ed. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1980. (First published in 1937.)
Quine, W. V. O. “On Frege’s Way Out.” Mind 64 (1955): 145-59.
Russell, Bertrand. Correspondence with Frege. In Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence, by Gottlob Frege. Translated by Hans Kaal. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1980.
Russell, Bertrand. The Principles of Mathematics. 2d. ed. Reprint, New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 1996. (First published in 1903.)
Zermelo, Ernst. “Investigations in the Foundations of Set Theory I.” In From Frege to Gödel, ed. by Jean van Heijenoort. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1967. (First published in 1908.)

Author Information

Kevin C. Klement
Email: klement@philos.umass.edu
University of Massachusetts, Amherst
U. S. A.

Palaestrae

These establishments were used for training youths in boxing and wrestling and were also frequented by Socrates and other philosophers. This article contains a discussion of the locations of the palaestrae (wrestling schools) that are known to have existed in Athens, and the the function of these establishments.

Table of Contents

Locations
Function
References and Further Reading

1. Locations

Palaestrae were an integral part of larger gymnasia (areas for general physical training and athletics) and are attested for the three well-known gymnasia areas of Athens (the Academy [Hyperides,Demosthenes, fr. 6], Cynosarges [Diogenes Laertius, 6.30.8 and Aelian, True History 8.14.3], and Lyceum [Pseudo-Plutarch, Lives of the Orators 841d and 843f]). These schools for training in combat sports also existed separately from gymnasia in the city of Athens itself and in the countryside.

As a result of the difficulty of archaeological exploration amidst the urban sprawl of modern Athens, even the general locations of most of the palaestrae outside the major gymnasia areas of Archaic and Classical Athens and Attica are not known with certainty. Only two urban Athenian palaestrae may be roughly located: the palaistra of Taureas and the palaistra where Mikkos was a sophist. The palaistra of Taureas is said by Plato ( Charmides 153a, Lucian, Parasite 43) to have been opposite the sanctuary of Basile. Neither the sanctuary nor the palaistra may be located with any certainty, however, despite Travlos’ confident statement that a boundary stone marking an unnamed sanctuary near the corner of modern Syngrou Blvd. and Hatzichristou St. refers to the sanctuary of Basile (Travlos, PDA 332 and fig. 435). The palaistra where Mikkos taught is said by Plato to have been near the Panops fountain, which has been placed in the neighborhood of the Diochares Gates in Northeast Athens (Ritchie, “Lyceum” 253-254 and Travlos, PDA 159-160).

There were palaestrae in the Attic countryside as well. For example, the sanctuary of Artemis at Brauron had both a gymnasium and a palaestra (SEG XL 91). Kephissia possessed a palaistra ( SEG XXXII 147) and it is likely that many of the other demes, especially large ones like Acharnae and Aphidna, had their own as well. There is also the case of the so-called “Palaestra of Cercyon,” a palaestra belonging to a mythical person, but associated with an actual place along the Eleusis-Megara road (Bacchylides 18.26, Scholia of Arethas on Lucian 21.21). The travel writer Pausanias (1.39.3) himself visited the site.

Other palaestrae mentioned by the ancient sources include the place where Ariston of Argos trained Plato as a youth (Apuleius, On Plato 1.2 and Suda, s.v. Platon), the palaestra of Hippocrates (Pseudo-Plutarch, Lives of the Orators 837e) where Isocrates died in 337 BC, and the palaestra of Sibyrtios (Plutarch, Alcibiades 3) where a follower of Alcibiades was killed. For the other palaestrae mentioned by the ancient sources there is no indication of place or even number (Kratinos, fr. 176, Lysias, fr. 6.1Teisis, Theophrastus, Characters 7.5, Aelian Varia Historia 4.24.2, Pollux, Onomastica 2.13); some of these unnamed palaestrae may refer to the same structures or they may be independent facilities.

The palaestrae in the Academy, Brauron, Cynosarges, and Lyceum would have come under the superintendence of the cult officials who oversaw the larger gymnasia areas. Other palaestrae appear to have been overseen and regulated by public officials, such as the paidotribes or epistates (Aeschines,Against Timarchus 10). The only firm evidence for the private ownership of a palaestra comes from Theophrastus, who appears in this instance to be describing in extreme and unflattering terms a small, poorly constructed home palaestra (Theophrastus, Characters 21.15-16).

2. Function

The very name palaestra derives from the verb palaiein, meaning “to wrestle.” Palaestrae had three basic functions: (1) as training areas for combat sports such as wrestling and boxing, (2) as areas for cult activity, and (3) as meeting places for discussion, philosophical and otherwise. Plato’s depiction of Socrates engaging in philosophical discourse provides a most vivid picture of life in the Classical Athenian palaestrae. For example, in Plato’s Lysis, it is a palaistra into which Socrates is drawn for a discussion of Eros (Sexual Love) and Philia (Friendship). Within the palaestra, boys play at games with knucklebones and engage in the more serious business of sacrificing to Hermes (Plato, Lysis 206c, Scholia of Arethas on Plato Lysis 206c, Proklos On Plato’s Alcibiades 1.195.4). Older men sit on the edges of the enclosure discussing the physical and moral merits of the young men. In P lato’s Charmides a similar scene is painted. In this dialogue Socrates returns from battle at Potidaea to the palaestra of Taureas, which is described as one of his regular haunts, and engages Critias and his young cousin Charmides in a discussion of sophrosyne or “temperance.”

Plato’s choice of the palaestra as a setting for two Socratic dialogues is no accident. Wrestling metaphors recur throughout the Platonic dialogues. For example, in the Phaedrus the conquest of the baser part of the soul by the virtuous part is compared with a wrestling victory in the Olympic games (256b, also compare Protagoras 350e). In part, this use of wrestling metaphors may be an autobiographical touch on the part of Plato, as later tradition tells us that he himself was successful as a young wrestler at the Nemean games (Suda, s.v. Platon). However, the placement of Socrates, a philosopher of the most active sort, amidst those training to fight is most apt. After all, Socrates always sought intellectual contests, not so much for the winning, he would say, but for gaining insight into the truth.

Both as a locale for philosophical discussion and teaching and as a metaphor for a struggle for the truth, palaestrae would continue to be used by philosophers throughout antiquity and become a common leitmotif in the writings of the Church Fathers of Late Antiquity and the Early Middle Ages.

3. References and Further Reading

W. Morison, “Attic Gymnasia and Palaistrai: Public or Private?” The Ancient World 31.2 (2000) 140-143.
W. Morison, “An Honorary Deme Decree and the Administration of a Palaistra in Kephissia,” Zeitschrift für Papyrologie und Epigraphik 131 (2000) 93-98.
S. Glass, “The Greek Gymnasium: Some Problems,” in The Archaeology of the Olympics, ed. W.J. Raschke. Madison 1988.
C.E. Ritchie, “The Lyceum, the Garden of Theophrastos and the Garden of the Muses. A Topographical Reevaluation,” in Philia epê. Athens 1986-1989.
J. Travlos, Pictorial Dictionary of Ancient Athens. Athens 1971.
Wycherley, R.E. The Stones of Athens. Princeton 1978.

Author Information

William Morison
Email: morisonw@gvsu.edu
Grand Valley State University

John Locke: Political Philosophy

locke John Locke (1632-1704) presents an intriguing figure in the history of political philosophy whose brilliance of exposition and breadth of scholarly activity remains profoundly influential.

Locke proposed a radical conception of political philosophy deduced from the principle of self-ownership and the corollary right to own property, which in turn is based on his famous claim that a man earns ownership over a resource when he mixes his labour with it. Government, he argued, should be limited to securing the life and property of its citizens, and is only necessary because in an ideal, anarchic state of nature, various problems arise that would make life more insecure than under the protection of a minimal state. Locke is also renown for his writings on toleration in which he espoused the right to freedom of conscience and religion (except when religion was deemed intolerant!), and for his cogent criticism of hereditary monarchy and patriarchalism. After his death, his mature political philosophy leant support to the British Whig party and its principles, to the Age of Enlightenment, and to the development of the separation of the State and Church in the American Constitution as well as to the rise of human rights theories in the Twentieth Century.

However, a closer study of any philosopher reveals aspects and depths that introductory caricatures (including this one) cannot portray, and while such articles seemingly present a completed sketch of all that can ever be known of a great thinker, it must always be remembered that a great thinker is rarely captured in a few pages or paragraphs by a lesser one, or one that approaches him with particular philosophical interest or bias: the reader, once contented with the glosses provided here, should always return to and scrutinise Locke in the original – just as an academic exposition of Beethoven’s Eroica symphony will always be a sallow reflection of the actual music.

This article summarises the general drift of Locke’s political thinking, leaving the other IEP article on Locke to examine his general philosophy and his theory of knowledge. The article touches on his biography as it relates to the development of his political thought, and it also provides an analysis of some of the issues that his philosophy raises – especially with regards to the Two Treatises of Government. Locke is rightly famous for his Treatises, yet during his life he repudiated his authorship, although he subtly recommended them as essential reading in letters and thoughts on reading for gentlemen. The Treatises swiftly became a classic in political philosophy, and its popularity has remained undiminished since his time: the ‘John Locke academic industry’ is vibrant and broad with an academic journal (John Locke Studies) and books regularly coming out dealing with his philosophy.

Reading Locke: An overview of his political philosophy.
Political Life
Locke’s Political Writings
Shaftesbury Era
Two Treatises
1. First Treatise
2. Second Treatise
Analysis of Locke’s Two Treatises
References and Further Reading
1. Abbreviations Used
2. Secondary Sources

1. Reading Locke: An overview of his political philosophy

The first caveat to note is that Locke’s political philosophy is divided into two discernible eras – his Oxford period (1652-66) and his Shaftesbury period, when he was employed by Lord Anthony Ashley-Cooper (later Earl of Shaftesbury) from 1666-1683 through his final years following Shaftesbury’s death. The ‘two Lockes’ are somewhat distinguishable and should certainly be born in mind, even if one were to concentrate solely on his Two Treatises, and ignore his earlier thinking. Nonetheless, the Treatises, written in his later incarnation should be read not just as classics in their own right but as the mature culmination of Locke’s political philosophy into an original and insightful theory of government, power, property, trust, and rights, for there are Lockean continuities in his political thinking that reach back into his earliest political sketches. For example, scriptural exegesis used to support his political ideas, and his fear of violence (national and towards him and his friends), uncertainty, war, and accordingly of any doctrine or behaviour that could lead to unsettling anarchy or persecution. It was a fear of persecution that kept him from admitting to authorship of the Two Treatises, after all Seventeenth Century Britain certainly produced many provocative and extreme opinions, and indeed a few writers, including some close associates, were executed for their seditious thoughts. Locke retained a fear for his life long after the troubles had died down.

The earlier Locke, a student and tutor at Oxford, was morally and politically conservative, Hobbesian one could say were such thoughts not so generally reflective of the post-bellum times in England in which strong and stable government was manifestly preferable to the apparent anarchy of the recent Civil Wars in the British Isles (1642-51). The mature Locke developed into a radical proponent of religious freedom, individual liberty and conscience. By no means did he become an anarchist or a thorough and consistent libertarian who decried the use of power – power, he believed, is essential to the running of a peaceful commonwealth, but it must be vigorously checked and controlled, as well as used to secure national interests. His later writings are certainly in the vein of what is now termed ‘classical liberalism’ upholding the sanctity of private property, self-ownership, minimal government, and the innate distrust of the use of power, yet throughout his political theorising and despite the later emphasis towards inviolable rights, he remains, politically conservative, economically mercantilist, morally authoritarian, highly Christian, and generally suspicious of swathes of people who could affect the Commonwealth’s peace and security (atheists, Quakers, Roman Catholics). Locke also enjoyed dabbling in rationalist designs for how societies ought to be run, which is far removed from the hero of libertarian thinking of live and let live that he is sometimes held to be.

For example, Locke retained an Oxford born academic scepticism of the people (tinted with a sense of noblesse oblige – he left money for the poor of the parishes of his birth and death) well into his Shaftesbury years, but this is later admixed with his political experiences in which he gained a healthier cynicism of those who wield power and of their effects on what he increasingly believed ought to remain private and thus beyond the remit of the magistrate. Throughout Locke’s writings those who would threaten or undermine government through their intolerance, leanings toward papal theocracy, or indulging in bone idleness are castigated and are to be outlawed according to his schemes: inconsistencies or at least intolerances or prudential considerations linger within his general libertarian framework. Indeed, writing in 1669 Locke accepts the institution of slavery (FCC) and as late as 1697 (a good decade and a half after writing the Two Treatises), he advises press-ganging beggars into military service and that begging minors should be “soundly whipped.” (EPL).

The second caveat is that Locke’s works deserve re-reading – only then, or even after several attempts, can one begin to enjoy the humour that sometimes punctuates the texts, and to see that Locke’s apparently circumlocutory style belies a great depth of thought peppered with qualifications and sub-clauses which are employed to tighten his argument. Locke neither rants from the extremes nor wraps his language in poetical mysticism to awe the superstitious, nor does he proffer snippets of profound metaphysical insights to satiate the quick reader. As a medical doctor and amateur scientist and the author of the classical work on epistemology and psychology, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1689, published the same year as the Two Treatise), it’s not surprising that Locke’s political writings are methodical and tightly argued. Locke’s arguments lifted from his texts present an uncompromising and modern vision of empiricism and scientific enquiry; however, his language is immersed in Old Testament anecdotes and references that when we peruse his writings, we must remember that John Locke was of Seventeenth Century Puritan and Scholastic background, and at Oxford he studied amidst the general University contract of religious uniformity until his departure on a freer, if relatively unsure foot, in employment with the politically ambitious courtier Lord Ashley.

The next section reviews Locke’s political biography and although it may be skipped for those interested in a cursory glance at the political arguments of the Two Treatises, it is of invaluable background for a more profound understanding.

2. Political Life

This section outlines the broad political events surrounding Locke’s life and thereby provides a useful, although not exhaustive, sketch of the man and the context of his works.

The Seventeenth Century was a period of immense upheavals – across Europe the Thirty Years Wars had raged (1608-48), and in Locke’s Britain, Civil War broke out in 1642: “I no sooner perceived myself in the world but I found myself in a storm.” (FT). He lived through the overthrow and execution of the monarch, the interregnum of the Cromwell’s Republic, the Restoration, and the overthrow of another monarch in the Glorious Revolution. Without some knowledge of this political context and thus the world in which he wrote and acted, it is difficult to understand the thrust of Locke’s political philosophy.

John Locke was born in 1632 in a cottage in the village of Wrington, near the great port of Bristol, Somerset, and was raised at Pensford a few miles to the west. The second Stuart King of England, Wales, Scotland, and Ireland had been on the throne for seven years – the ill-fated Charles I, whose reign was to lead to a brutal Civil War dividing the British along religious and political lines and which ended in his execution in 1649. Somerset was one of the most populous and rich counties of the country, yet despite its affluence gained from hard work and a division of labour, social strata (albeit highly flexible since Tudor times) permeated social relations – each individual had a moral superior to look up to in a moral hierarchy that ended with the monarch, whose superior was God. This political and social context is vital to be aware of, for the tensions and violence of the era permeate the atmosphere in which Locke matured and wrote his political writings.

The essential divisions that operated in the Civil Wars may be thought of as splitting Puritan or Independent religious proponents with supporters of the rights of Parliament (generally lumped into ‘Parliamentarians’) from adherents to the Anglican Church, closet Catholics, and supporters of the Royal Establishment (generally referred to as ‘Royalists’). Locke’s parents were low gentry Puritans (tanners and clothiers), and his father, an attorney to the local Justices of the Peace, went to war on the Parliamentarian side in the cavalry. The local city of Bristol was a Royalist stronghold during the wars but fell to the Parliamentarians in 1645, and in 1647, a good acquaintance of Locke’s father, officer and Member of Parliament for the West Country, Alexander Popham, secured young Master Locke a place at Westminster School in London in the first example of patronage that was to assist Locke’s career.

Locke’s family instilled him good values of independence and self-discipline, which he retained throughout his life, but the move to London opened up Locke’s mind and took him far from his parochial Puritan upbringing (Dunn). Westminster School was run by the formidable Dr Richard Busby, a Royalist, who was apparently fond of beating the boys, something the older Locke was to recommend for young beggars. Young Locke was there the same time as the poet and future apologist for Charles II, John Dryden (1644-54) and was at school at the time of Charles I’s execution on the scaffolding erected in front of the nearby Banqueting House (Jan. 1649). The execution caused a sympathetic reaction to the Royalist cause to foment during the next decade – and a posthumously published pamphlet, allegedly written by Charles (Eikon Basilike) encouraged the raising of his status from traitor (in the eyes of the High Court that tried him) to one of martyr, and it popularised not just the Stuart doctrine that the Stuarts (or monarchs in general) were divinely appointed (rather than chancing upon the throne of England – the last Tudor monarch, Elizabeth I died without issue), but that Parliamentarians were guilty of the heinous crime of regicide.

a. Oxford

In 1652 the twenty year old Locke moved onto Oxford’s Christ Church.

Oxford had enjoyed an influx of scientific inquiry and humanism – Roger Bacon (1220-92), John Wycliffe (1330-84), Desiderius Erasmus (1469-1536) and Sir Thomas More (1477-1535), all had their influence on the colleges. The present head of Christ Church for Locke was the Presbyterian John Owen (1616-83), a Puritan proponent of toleration and independence for Protestant sects and an earlier supporter and follower of Oliver Cromwell (1599-1658). (Owen travelled with Cromwell into his wars in Scotland and Ireland). Avoiding a career in theology and despising the dry Scholasticism (although the techniques and knowledge were of great use to his mind), Locke concentrated his studies on medical science at Oxford and later held teaching and diplomatic positions until meeting up with Lord Ashley Cooper in 1666 (later Earl of Shaftesbury). The position of a don was Locke’s preferred ambition and would have loved to live his whole life at Oxford – but events altered this path and he was illegally ejected on political grounds in 1684 from his studentship at Christ Church.

Locke’s politically formative years as a young man were dominated by the rise of Puritan dissenters and Parliamentarians, the outbreak of Civil War when he was ten, the fall of Bristol when he was 13, the execution of Charles I when he was 17 and the formation and government of a Republic until he was 28. His religious thinking had shifted from a traditional acceptance of his Puritan heritage to Latitudinarianism, which emphasises the employment of reason in understanding religious and Scriptural matters. A constant political problem he drew his attention to was the rights of the civil magistrates relative to the rights of the clergy; up until the mid-1660s, Locke espoused the primacy of civil institutions in defining the nation’s religious culture and forms – he was, in effect, an advocate of the earlier Acts of Supremacy (1534, 1559) establishing the Monarch as the head of the Church and State, and the Elizabethan Act of Uniformity (1559) that sought to unify religious worship in the Kingdom; the Republic contrarily had promoted diversity.

The Lords and the Monarchy were abolished by the reforming Republic, and Cromwell defeated Royalist and Catholic forces in Ireland (viciously at Drogheda [Droichead Átha] and Wexford [Loch Garman] in1649) and Charles II’s army in Scotland. John Lambert (1619-1684) penned the first British Constitution to give the Republic a stable form. The position of Lord Protector was created, which was passed to Cromwell. However, political divisions beset the Republic, which teetered into a dictatorship as Cromwell became increasingly frustrated with his attempts at reforming the country. Nonetheless, Cromwell was, in many respects, a highly capable ruler – rejecting the offered crown to become a de jure monarch, and realising what a political vacuum the dissolution of the monarchy implied he appointed good judges to ensure the rule of law, encouraged religious toleration, liberty of conscience and the immigration of Jews. The Republic was a strange political beast, taking over in a country wracked by war the powers that the Tudors and early Stuarts (James I and Charles I) had arrogated to themselves, and whose traditional, but by then very well worn down, checks on arbitrary executive and legislative power were thereby diminished. It is unsurprising that the country swiftly descended into a military dictatorship under Oliver Cromwell’s rule. The Republic became a pariah state, and European (notably the French) monarchs sought to assist Charles II to regain his throne.

The immanent political difficulties led to the Republic’s rapid demise following Cromwell’s death, and the ‘Long Parliament’ (whose Members were initially summoned by Charles I in 1640 and which was recalled by General Monck) soon sought out the exiled King Charles II to bring peace and calm to the vulnerable state. Yet relief following Charles’s return in 1660 soon turned to grave concern in many parts of the country, and the problems that had beset or been unleashed in the previous two decades of war and interregnum resurfaced.

In 1660, John Locke was aged twenty eight and a newly appointed tutor in Greek at Oxford. Oxford and Locke prudently rejoiced in the Restoration in a commissioned book of poetry: “Our prayers are heard,” penned Locke – but so had he and his Oxford colleagues praised Cromwell’s rule, “You, mighty Prince!” (V) Initially, Locke was unwilling to add to the political controversies of the era, until he penned his first two Tracts on Government. The occasion was a highly controversial reversal of policy on the part of Charles’s government.

In 1662 Charles II’s government passed a new Act of Uniformity, which Locke supported in his Tracts as being within the monarch’s rights. But the repercussions were severe. The Puritans and Parliamentarians had originally supported Charles’s restoration as being the most peaceful alternative the country possessed in 1660, and they had been assured that there would be a broad toleration of “tender consciences” as Charles described the beliefs of the various independent branches of Protestantism then flourishing in the Kingdom. However, the Uniformity Act dashed Puritan hopes for toleration. The Act and subsequent legislation ejected two thousand Puritan ministers from their churches, fined anyone over 16 attending ceremonies not conducted by the Anglican Book of Common Prayer, and forced ex-Puritan ministers to live at least five miles away from where they used to preach. An intolerant Act passed so soon after the dissolution of the Commonwealth caused concern and rebellion in parts of the Kingdom – nevertheless Locke was more of the opinion that the magistrate (King) possessed the right to demand uniformity, with the caveat that in their consciences men may remain free in order to secure peace in a troubled land. It was an opinion he gradually moved away from.

In 1666, Locke returned to Oxford from a year in Brandenburg (in modern Germany) acting as secretary to the diplomat Sir Walter Vane, and at Oxford Locke was introduced to a man who was to change his life, of whom it has been said that without him there would have been no ‘Locke’. To understand Locke’s change from a political conservative accepting the magistrate’s right to rule as both prudential and moral to a radical supporter of the individual against the government, it is worth considering a few details of Ashley’s life.

b. Shaftesbury

Anthony Ashley Cooper (1621-83) was a wealthy and politically powerful patron to work for, and Ashley worked for whomever was in power – Royalists, Parliamentarians, the Protectorate, and the Restoration monarchy. He had initially sided with Charles I in the first Civil War, but changed sides to fight with the Parliamentarians having become displeased with the political and religious advice afforded the King. He supported Cromwell and was promoted well till he became dissatisfied with the increasingly military leaning of the Protectorate (1653-54). A year after Cromwell’s death in 1660, Ashley sat on the commission for the Convention Parliament that invited Charles II to return to England; although Ashley was not a thoroughly enthusiastic supporter of the Restoration, it appeared to many Presbyterians to be the most prudential step for the country to take. From 1660-73 Ashley worked for Charles II, eventually rising to become Chancellor – and was promoted to an Earldom in 1672. Ashley argued for religious toleration for dissenting Protestants and supported the Anglo-Dutch wars on mercantilist grounds (Dutch profit equates to English losses), but his anti-Catholic stance eventually led to his dismissal from government.

Ashley actively engaged Parliament to keep Charles II’s brother, James, an open Catholic, from marrying another Catholic and from becoming King. James, the then Duke of York, was also a capable and efficient Lord High Admiral of the Fleet and had taken New Amsterdam from the Dutch in 1664, having it renamed New ‘York’; he later fought in the Anglo-Dutch wars. Initially, James had the backing of the establishment – he was more serious and thus more appreciable to the Anglicans, and he leaned towards toleration. However, his very Catholicism worried those of a more puritan and cynical leaning.

Out of office and in opposition, Shaftesbury formed ‘the Country Party’ to criticise the King’s government. From this evolved the first two political parties of modern times – the Whigs and the Tories. (The Whigs generally speaking followed Shaftesbury and the Tories supported the Anglican establishment). However, in 1679, a spurious plot was uncovered to assassinate Charles II to instate his Catholic brother on the throne; this gave Shaftesbury’s political stance momentum and growth, for the country feared a return to Catholic Stuart rule and the conditions that had created the Civil Wars. In 1681, Shaftesbury marched to Parliament with a force of men, but the King’s dissolution of the Parliament left him suddenly vulnerable – he was imprisoned and charged with treason, a charge rejected by the jury. The poet laureate and Westminster graduate, John Dryden, penned a satirical attack on Shaftesbury at this time (Absalom and Achitophel) and a year later Shaftesbury fled to Holland and died in exile in 1683.

c. Locke and Shaftesbury

Returning to how all this affected Locke’s life, in 1666 Lord Ashley had happened to go to Oxford to see his doctor about a liver complaint. Locke was introduced to him and the two became good friends. Locke gained employment at the heart of Lord Ashley’s household in London following the Great Fire until 1675. In 1668 he oversaw a life-saving operation on his patron to remove liver cists.

Locke learned much from Shaftesbury. For example, his first Essay on Toleration marked a substantial shift away from his earlier establishmentarian views that the ruler should prescribe the form of religious service for the country. This was very reflective of Lord Ashley’s philosophy of encouraging toleration rather than division. Debate had heated up following the Act of Uniformity (1662), and in Scotland, the Covenanters, who opposed any form of episcopalianism (hierarchical rule of bishops and archbishops) and uniformity, suffered brutally. There were various uprisings in Scotland in 1666, 1679, and 1685, which had led to thousands of martyrs burning at the stake and being hanged for their opposition. (Visitors to Edinburgh may see where they were burned in the Grass Market and visit a memorable commemorative grave in Greyfriar’s graveyard).

In 1668 Locke was elected to the Royal Society, and as his patron rose to become Chancellor for Charles II, Locke served the Lords Proprietors of Carolina (helping to draft a Constitution for the plantation), Secretary for Presentations (dealing with church livings), and Secretary to the Council of Trade and Plantations. His employment kept him busy from philosophical thought – but no doubt gave him invaluable experience of the workings of power and the court.

In 1675 Charles’ brother and heir to the throne James publicly converted to Catholicism and caused the expected crisis that left Lord Ashley – now Earl of Shaftesbury – ejected from office and in opposition. From 1675-79, an unwell Locke travelled to France, returning to London in 1679-81 with his master to enjoy the heat of the Exclusion Crisis in which Shaftesbury and his supporters sought a Parliamentary Act to exclude James from taking the throne.

In 1680 the late Sir Robert Filmer’s Patriarcha was published at the height of the Exclusion Crisis. Filmer (1588-1653) had written his work in 1648 supporting the divine right of Kings and their absolute power over the land. James I had given his support to the medieval notion that a ruler is divinely appointed (a theory designed to secure the monarch’s power in relation to the Church), but a few decades later it was given a theoretical defence by Filmer (and later by Jacques-Benigne Bossuet (1627-1704) in Louis XIV’s France) – Locke was to reply with his Two Treatises, rejecting Filmer’s theory as ‘glib nonsense’ and the evidence is that Locke began writing his Treatises not long after purchasing a copy of Patriarcha.

In 1681 however, Locke’s patron, Shaftesbury, was charged with treason following ‘the Rye House Plot’ of an alleged attempt to kill Charles and James. The jury rejected the charge against Shaftesbury, but Tory political advances prompted Shaftesbury, in the absence of any hope of a Parliament sitting to provide support to his party, to flee to Holland where he died in 1683. Two of his colleagues opposing James’s succession, Algernon Sidney and Lord William Russell, were, however, executed, while a third, the Earl of Essex, committed suicide. Sidney’s Discourses Concerning Government (published posthumously in 1698) had argued for a right to revolt and his words were used against him during his trial; Russell had withdrawn from public life, but informers inculpated him in the Plot to assassinate Charles II.

The intolerant and charged atmosphere kept Locke abroad from 1683-89 and freedom from political intrigues and duties allowed him to develop his philosophy.

In 1685 Charles II died and his brother James ascended the throne. The ripples from the Rye House Plot continued to upset the initially stable and sober new regime, and after the failed Monmouth and Argyll rebellions (1685) to oust James, the new monarch clamped down on those who sought to overthrow him. James subsequently handed out army posts to supporting and trustworthy Catholics, and he advanced Catholics to his Privy Council; in November he dismissed Parliament. Nonetheless, he tolerantly presented a Declaration of Indulgences permitting Catholic and Non-Conformist freedom – the motives for which remain unclear; but the Queen’s pregnancy and the possibility of a Catholic succession led Protestant leaders to consult with James’ daughter’s husband (and her cousin – both sharing Charles I as grandfather!), William of Orange in Holland. William had been fighting the might of Catholic France with much gusto and success. Accordingly, as James became increasingly unstable and a boy (James) was born to his wife, William was invited over to take the throne. Upon landing in South Devon and marching toward London many of James’s officers immediately switched sides and James fled to France. Soon both the English and Scots Parliaments declared the de facto abdication of James and the accession of William in what is often called the ‘Glorious Revolution’.

Locke returned to England with William’s wife, Mary, and other exiles. The ousted James had lost all his military abilities and an attempt at recovering his throne via an invasion of hope of a sympathetic uprising in Ireland led to his defeat by William at the Battle of the Boyne in 1690.

These were certainly times of political commotion. In 1689, Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding was published, along with, anonymously, his Two Treatises and a Letter Concerning Toleration. Amendments to the Two Treatises present it as work defending the ‘Glorious Revolution’ and William and Mary’s accession to the throne at the consent of the English people, although modern research has dated it back to 1679-81 and the occasion of Patriarcha’s publication.

Locke returned to England and settled at the house of Sir Francis and Lady Damaris Masham. Damaris was the daughter of Ralph Cudworth (1617-88), a Cambridge platonist, whose writings Locke had enjoyed and which had influenced his shift towards Latitudinarianism. Amidst friends and in a politically more cordial environment, Locke published works on economics, the Scriptures, toleration, and education. In 1695 he advised on the ending of press censorship, and was appointed a member of the Board of Trade (1696-1700). His Essay Concerning Human Understanding gathered pace – drawing controversy and support and earning a translation into French in 1700. Locke died with Lady Damaris reading the Psalms to him. His death, she wrote, “was like his life, truly pious, yet natural, easy and unaffected.” (Aaron)

3. Locke’s Political Writings

Locke was initially reluctant to compose political tracts, which he considered, very much like Thomas Hobbes does in his Behemoth, as producing more conflict than men’s swords. Nonetheless, at Christ Church, Oxford, he penned two key essays on the extent of toleration, the most disruptive and contentious issue of the time – the Two Tracts on Government and his lectures on the Law of Nature, the latter written as Censor of Moral Philosophy at Christ Church.

a. Oxford Writings (1652-1667)

In a century of religious and civil wars, Locke understandably sought to explore the limits to toleration that a state should permit its citizens in their choice and manner of religious expression and worship. Toleration and how men ought to lead their lives are two central themes to Locke’s entire political philosophy, yet it is remarkable, if one approaches his works from the Two Treatises, how politically conservative and accepting he was at Oxford both of the Restoration and Charles’s later Act of Uniformity. The Two Tracts were penned on the occasion of the Restoration of the Monarchy, in which Puritans hoped for continued toleration for their practices and beliefs as they had enjoyed under Cromwell.

b. Two Tracts on Government

Locke’s Two Tracts on Government (1660 and 1662), not published until the 20th Century, form a reply to his fellow student at Christ Church, Edward Bagshaw, who had published and argued for religious authenticity and a rejection of the state’s attempt at religious uniformity, and whose friends and pupils had stolen priests’ surplices in reaction to what they (rightly) perceived as a political shift towards religious uniformity. Bagshaw was a Presbyterian who was in general agreement with Locke’s thesis but who vehemently disagreed with the Anglicanisation of religion that the Act required.

Locke begins with how disruptive the religious “scribblings” of the age have been to his country, pens causing “as much guilt as their swords.” While acknowledging his respect for both authority and liberty, Locke prefers to steer a middle path observing that liberty may “turn loose to the tyranny of a religious rage,” unless its outward form is subjected to the state’s jurisdiction – that is, religious dissent should be subservient to the need to secure the peace, and thus the people ought to accept the religious policy of the presiding regimes.

In forming a Commonwealth, Locke argues, in strong Hobbesian echoes, a man should give up his liberty to the magistrate, “and [entrust] the magistrate with as full a power over all his actions as he himself hath.” Avoiding any discussion of the divine right to rule (which he later takes up in the Two Treatises), Locke claims that the magistrate ought to be the sole judge, even if elected by the people, of ‘matters indifferent’ – i.e., the form and manner in which a people worship. Not only should such matters be given up to the wisdom of the magistrate but the people are also obliged to obey. Christ commanded obedience, he notes, and after all, the magistrate looks to the public welfare, while the individual citizen seeks only his own interest. Implicatively, self-interested pursuit in resolving ‘matters indifferent’ would lead to clashes were they not put in the hands of the magistrate – the ruler.

Yet the ruler’s ability to mould the citizenry is limited to what can be seen, Locke adds. This is an important caveat that develops with an increasing emphasis over his life: a man’s conscience is private, so the magistrate can only influence the obedience of the “outward man.” Immersed in the classics as he was at Oxford, we can note that this is a particularly Roman, prudential consideration of religion which initially caused much harm for Christians: so long as conquered peoples outwardly worshipped the current Roman gods, native religious dispositions and consciences were tolerated – the Christians, however, refused to acquiesce in such ‘matters indifferent’ and many martyrs were created (something the Scottish Covenanters were keen to mimic). Of this and of the recent religious turmoil in his land, Locke is keenly aware – the ruler “cannot cast men’s minds and manners into one mould,” but he is optimistic that the magistrate will use only those powers that are in sympathy with the people and the time in easing them into the same Church. After all, Locke surmises from monastic Oxford, the ruler is supposed to be wise.

In what does more danger lie, Locke rhetorically asks – in the hands of a single, wise man, or an ignorant mob? “From an orderly council or a confused multitude?” The dilemma echoes the Platonic vision of politics and indeed, Locke deploys the perennially popular analogy used by all statists from Plato onwards of the need for a capable captain of the ship (cf. Plato’s Republic, Book VI), which assumes that the citizens are on a single ship and not a flotilla all seeking their own purposes; this collectivist position of assuming we are mariners in desperate need of a swarthy captain, Locke was to alter (but never completely drop) in his Shaftesbury years. But at Oxford, he was quite taken with the metaphor: indeed he notes that such great captains who steer their nations wisely are those “whom the Scriptures calls gods” compared to the multitudinous “beasts”.

The academician Locke highlights his distrust of the masses and prefers to put political control in the hands of a few rather than the many. The multitude is “always craving, never satisfied” and if they are given liberty in religion “where will they stop, where will they themselves bound it …?” It was “a liberty for tender consciences” (using Charles II’s description) that “was the first inlet to all those confusions and unheard of and destructive opinions that overspread this nation” in the Civil Wars. No, mankind is not to be trusted with liberty of religion, Locke urges: “there had been no design so wicked which hath not worn the vizor of religion, nor rebellion not been so kind to itself as to assume the specious name of reformation” that have drawn men into war with promises of liberty and glory. “Hence the cunning and malice of men taken occasion to pervert the doctrine of peace and charity into a perpetual foundation of war and contention.”

Whilst upholding the innate pacifism of Christianity and the horror of wars waged in its name, Locke is of the opinion that permitting men the choice and freedom to worship will create havoc and violence as each sect will take arms to fight those they judge to be offensive “and so in the actions of the greatest cruelty applaud themselves as good Christians.” Hence the magistrate ought to look for the good of society and secure the peace between men.

In the Second Tract, Locke stresses the Christian duty of obedience to the magistrate – invoking implicitly Christ’s ambiguous answer to the Pharisees: “render to Caesar the things that are Caesar’s, and to God the things that are God’s.” But what does a magistrate do? For the early Locke, the ruler’s job is to be responsible for the care of the community – to preserve the public good and keep the people in peace. What the particular policies a magistrate ought to follow depends, Locke admits, on contemporary conventions and expectations, but the magistrate is in the best position to judge in light of the times what ought to be the best policy and what ought to be orderly and decent.

The magistrate symbolises the apex of natural power and order in the world – at least from Locke’s Protestant Oxford perspective. Whether “some are born to rule others” as Aristotle argued, or that men are all born into equality, or monarchs are divinely appointed, Locke, at this point in his intellectual development, offers no conclusion and thereby avoids the foray bubbling all around him. Nonetheless, the Lockean magistrate ought to act without private interest in securing the nation’s peace, and the citizens ought to passively obey him – even if he steps over his constitutional boundaries, for “God wished there to be order, society, and government among men” so “in every commonwealth there must be supreme power.” To that power “God in his great wisdom and beneficence has relinquished [religious rites] to the discretion of the magistrate.” Deferring to the Almighty, “God in his great mercy appointed that Christian doctrine should be embraced by the soul and faith alone and that true worship should be fulfilled in public gatherings and outward actions.”

A more conservative philosopher, accepting of the newly Restored monarchy, one could not imagine from the perspective of the later writer of the Treatises. Yet are there glimmerings of the path Locke eventually takes? Certainly in the realm of private conscience, which Locke emphatically declares cannot be forced. A man has perfect liberty over his conscience (the “liberty of judgement”). If the magistrate commands what has already been divinely commanded, then the citizen is obliged to obey and such laws can not be unjust for they do not bind a man’s conscience or his action. Similarly, legislation passed by a magistrate, “in so far as he is provided with legislative power”, may impose upon the liberty of the will in requiring outward assent and behaviour, but that leaves the conscience free to judge differently. However, if a magistrate seeks to constrain the liberty of judgement, then he sins – but, Locke quickly adds (just before the Act of Uniformity was passed), ecclesiastical rules are not likely to infringe upon people’s right to judge for they deal with ceremonial practice.

Against those who would fear the potential for magisterial abuse and who would allow religious liberty, Locke firstly describes them as the conjuring of “empty heads of these foolish men” and that if religious legislation were taken from the magistrate so too would be other legislation, and those who do not agree with Locke’s conservativism and thereby “take arms” against him will find himself in the “ranks set out above.” In doing so, the Oxford lecturer committed two fallacies – ad hominem (decrying an argument as false because of the person who utters it) and the slippery-slope fallacy (that if one thing were taken from the powers of the state, the state would lose all of its powers).

Yet the blatant contradiction in Locke’s attempt at resolving the political question of his time will fester and become increasingly apparent – if men have to go against their consciences to obey the magistrate, then they turn away from their God; if they disobey the magistrate in pursuit of their consciences, then they revolt against their monarch and the secular system of securing peace in the country. Locke cannot have it both ways and the realm and freedom of men’s consciences eventually win over political allegiance.

Also written at this time were some comments on Infallibility in which Locke outlines an orthodox Protestant attack on Catholicism. Catholic, “sharp-sighted priests have violated both these powers [making and interpreting laws] in their efforts to establish in every way that control over the conduct and consciences of men which they so strongly claim.” Yet such theory constituted the essence of Western political philosophy stretching back to the early centuries after the fall of Rome and the awkward relationship between the powers of the Church and the State. The Puritans of several sects logically rejected governmental or institutional interference in belief and their beliefs eventually forged the principle of absolute toleration in religious matters to which Locke was later to give his agreement and philosophical defence; but even in this very conservative phase, Locke’s non-conformist Protestant and Puritan upbringing is evident: interpretation should be left to the individual’s reading of the infallible Scriptures, not the alleged infallible interpretations of the priests. This would of course imply a rejection of any Act of Uniformity – of the imposition of Anglicanism and its Book of Common Prayer on the people. Nonetheless, Locke recoils, obedience is always the “safe and secure” path for the Christian congregation, for “the shepherds of the church can perhaps err while they are leading, but the sheep certainly cannot err while they are following.”

c. Essays on the Law of Nature (1663-1664)

In his Essays or lectures to students as Censor, teacher of Moral Philosophy at Christ Church, Locke argues that there is a Law of Nature – a basic system of morals – which is given to every man to know. The Essays were unpublished but circulated and had an influence on writers such as James Tyrell (1642-1718). His argument begins with an acceptance of God’s existence (“there will be no one to deny the existence of God” – and certainly not at Oxford, when subscribing to the Christian faith and the eventual taking of Holy Orders for tutors was a necessary condition of being admitted). The law, he adds, is something which is the decree of a superior will (God), and lays down what is to be done and not to be done, and which is binding on all men.

The moral law for Locke demands that some things are completely forbidden (theft, murder), others depend on certain sentiments, periodic duties, or conditional attitudes. These are binding on all equally, and despite the apparent relativism of morality, “no nation or human being is so removed from all humanity, so savage and so beyond the law, that it is not held by these bonds of law.” The moral law is a fixed and permanent set of morals, for “what is proper now for the rational nature [of man] … must needs be proper for ever, and the same reason will pronounce everywhere the same moral rules.” It is man’s nature that binds him to a universally binding moral law, which he cannot alter, despite his laziness and disposition to be led by others and follow the multitude or give into his passions.

Against the objection that the Law of Nature cannot be found, because not all people who possess reason have knowledge of it or that they will disagree over its content, Locke counters that possessing the faculty of reason does not necessitate its use. Some prefer living in ignorance, while others may be too dull, or are slaves to their passions to raise their intellect to what is required of them to understand the Natural Law, and others still are brought up amidst such evil that they become accustomed to it. Secondly, disagreement – what we now term moral relativism – does not indicate a lack of a law, but rather its existence.

In another glimmering of the development of Locke’s political and general philosophical thought, he examines the methods by which a man can know moral laws. (The theory of how we know things becomes a life-long quest for Locke, culminating in his Essay Concerning Human Understanding). It is obvious that the nature of the world is governed by laws and so too is man’s conduct, and that without moral laws, men would not have society; without moral law, trust between men would collapse. We can know moral laws through four different methods: inscription, tradition, sense experience, or divine revelation. Ignoring the last, Locke also rejects both inscription and tradition (which were both connected to Roman Catholic theology) in favour of learning morality with our senses and reason.

Following René Descartes’s methodology, which had turned him onto philosophy, Locke argues that sense experience proclaims the existence of a supreme law maker, a wise creator or the world, which has made man for a purpose. Man thus has purposes – to contemplate and to procure and preserve his life. Yet the moral law cannot be garnered from consent – from mass or democratic agreement, for the voice of the people is as likely to lead to fallacies and evil. Men’s actual morality may be highly relative, but differences do not undermine the existence of commonalties in the law, hence we should not obey (or follow) others blindly. Nonetheless, the conservative Locke continues to argue that we ought to obey our lawmakers as possessing rightful power over creation, but our obedience should not just be out of fear for the lawmaker’s power, but conscientiously too: we ought to obey it because the magistrate should request morally right action.

Yet there is detectable in Locke’s essay a growing suspicion of government. In conjecturing that a good policy is one that can be obey both without fear or without conscientious qualms, Locke is possibly indicating that the magistrate also has the responsibility not to provoke a rebellion of conscience in the people, words that may reflect the growing sense of concern that the Act of Uniformity engendered. There also creeps into his theorising a growing realisation of the limits to power’s use and the good it putatively brings about: the lawmaker possesses the right to impose his will on dissidents, but Locke advises that that power should be used only as a last resort.

In an interesting passage, wherein we can detect Locke’s philosophical abilities maturing, he discusses whether the Law of Nature can be said to be based on man’s self-interest. He rejects the Ancient Greek Carneades’ theory that all men act in the own interest, while he accepts the role that self-interest plays in the Law of Nature, “for the strongest protection of each man’s private property is the Law of Nature, without the observance of which it is impossible for anybody to be master of his own property and to pursue his own advantage.” Yet this is not quite anticipating Adam Smith’s theory of private profit leading to public advantage (Wealth of Nations, 1776), for Locke later accepts Montesquieu’s mercantilist (and ultimately Aristotelian) theory that one man’s gain is another’s loss; but what is of importance here is something we read of later in Hume’s criticism of self-interested pursuits. Some actions we deem moral, Locke remarks, can be personally costly – such as generosity and friendship, and while private profit may enrich some at the expense of others, “justice in one does not take equity away in another.” Similarly, if all were to pursue their own interest, that would imply that the individual would judge his own affairs and that can only lead to chaos, fraud, violence, and hatred.

After rejecting self-interest as a justification of natural law, Locke proceeds to reject the argument that utility forms the basis of the moral law. (It is always useful to know that what are often portrayed as 20th Century debates on, say, utilitarianism versus deontology, have a long philosophical pedigree). For Locke, it is not seeking to do good that produces morality, for whatever good does occur arises from the moral law: “utility is not the basis of the law or the ground of obligation, but the consequence of obedience to it.” (This is the position that Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) later espouses in his strict application of duty ethics.)

Interestingly, Locke adds that the moral law “neither supposes nor allows men to be inflamed with hatred for one another and to be divided into hostile states.” On the one hand, this belief may be considered as a theoretical attack on Hobbes’s description of the state of nature – that it is characterised by a war of all against all, yet that would be rather misplaced, for even in the state of nature, Hobbes’s musings are in agreement with Locke that natural laws (common ethical codes) apply to human interaction. On the other hand, it may be a philosopher’s warning to his government and the fanatics of the various religions and sects who were seeking to impose their vision and will on others.

The Two Tracts and the Essay are not political classics in the sense that political theorists, whose speciality is not the 17th Century, readily turn to them. But they contain philosophical elements and beliefs that Locke was to work on and develop – especially the role and limits to government, conscientious objection to the misuse of power, and religious freedom; although he was to dramatically alter his

4. Shaftesbury Era

On leaving the cloistered walls of Oxford to employment in Lord Ashley’s household, we detect a shift in Locke’s political thinking, away from the acceptance of the magistrate’s philosopher-king status towards Locke supposing him a man capable of erring like any other man. Indeed, Locke’s thought increasingly moves over the next few years from upholding passive obedience – and thus one’s station in life – to justifying rebellion when the magistrate oversteps certain boundaries, and in his Essay on Toleration we mark that change.

a. The Essay on Toleration (1667)

Locke is now concerned about the extremes of absolute obedience and absolute liberty in matters of conscience, a change in Locke’s priorities towards outlining the conditions under which a man ought to possess religious freedom and the limits – moral and prudential – of the magistrate’s powers. The Essay gives a better indication of the direction that Locke’s arguments take in the Two Treatises.

What is the purpose of government? It is to be used for the good, preservation, and the peace of men. If men could live peacefully, there would be no need for a magistrate, but patently the Seventeenth Century was strewn with war and its effects, and the thought of permitting a generally peaceful, anarchic state of nature was still too absurd for Locke to contemplate, so he dismisses it out of hand. He then deals strongly with those who would argue for a monarchy based on a divine right to rule, presaging the critique of the Two Treatises. Supporters of the divine right “have forgotten what country they are born in”, he writes.

In marked contrast to his Oxford phase, Locke now argues that in forming a government, “it cannot be supposed the people should give any one or more of their fellow men an authority over them for any other purpose than their own preservation, or extend the limits of their jurisdiction beyond the limits of this life.” This is indeed a shift from his Platonic vision of the goodly rational captain steering the ship! The magistrate ought to meddle with nothing but securing the peace. (In Scotland at this time, recall that the Covenanters were being put down for their rejection of Uniformity.) Yet we are still far from a libertarian thesis on a restricted government, for in outlining his principles of toleration, strict rules apply as to whom may be admitted into the tolerant club – Catholics and atheists need not apply. Within a broadly, pluralist Protestant nation though, toleration on ‘matters indifferent’ ought now to be practised by the magistrate on a scale relating to their epistemological status.

In matters speculative and divine worship a man ought to possess absolute liberty, for these are based on his subjective understanding of the nature of the universe and of God. In such areas of thought, no man may force his opinion on others – excepting atheists, for the are like ‘wild beasts’. In so arguing, Locke again adheres to a very Protestant (Puritan) theory of conscience and the individual’s relationship to God. Whereas the Catholic Church emphasises the role of priests and the theological hierarchy in reaching up to God, the Protestant reformers of the Church proclaimed the individual’s right to seek God by his own path, and Locke, following the Cambridge Platonists, emphasised the role of reason in understanding the relationship between man qua individual and God.

Toleration of others’ religious and speculative thinking is also politically prudential – so much misery had been generated by the state or various sects seeking to impose their will on others, and such antagonists are rarely motivated by religion than “depraved, ambitious human nature.” Thus, with regards to “matters indifferent”, Locke still insists that the government must look at their application to the nation’s peace and security, and may prohibit publications that tend to “the disturbance of government.” Toleration does not imply freedom of expression. Yet even here, since no man may be forced to alter his opinion, the citizens should obey the magistrate’s prescriptions and accept the state’s legislation as their consciences see fit “as far without violence they can.” In other words, if the state imposes forms of behaviour that a sect finds particularly offensive, it ought, for the peace and security of the nation as a whole, accept the laws (and not disrupt the peace in an “obstinate pursuit or flight”) leaving people’s consciences free to speculate as they see fit – in other words, they must give God and Caesar both their due. Some opinions must not be tolerated, if their natural tendency is absolutely destructive to society – so “faith may be broken with heretics.”

The third area that the magistrate may be concerned in involves the general moral virtues and vices of society. Interestingly, although these barely relate to acts of conscience, the state should not interfere here, for the magistrate has “nothing to do with the good of men’s souls.” This is a powerful departure from his previous stance as Censor and perhaps may be read as reflecting the licentiousness of Charles’s Court (which he surely must have known about from Ashley) and Locke’s acceptance of a distinction between tolerating private vices but not public ones. Nonetheless, the state may intervene in men’s affairs when their opinions are likely to be destructive of the society that harbours them – hence, for Locke, Catholicism is not to be tolerated. In other words, those who argue for theocracy ought to be restricted in their speech. The reason for this – and a mature political one – is that most men use power for their own advancement and those who are intolerant of others should in turn not be tolerated – such groups are not to be trusted with any path that may lead them to power and the overthrow of the liberties of others. Catholics in particular, when in power tend to “think themselves bound to deny it to others.” They ought to be handled “severely” Locke proposes.

Similarly, factions ought not to be tolerated if their numbers grow to threaten the state. Nevertheless, Locke is adamant that any attempt to use force to get others to change their opinions should be fully rejected as “the worst, the last to be used, and with the greatest caution.” Indeed, caution and prudence should be the watchwords of Locke’s theoretical government at this point in his thinking. Toleration of the various Protestant sects is the “readiest way to secure the safety and peace, and promote [public] welfare” and Protestant fanatics ought to be tolerated to be made useful and of assistance to the government rather than driving them into secrecy and unity through persecution. Again, Locke emphasises that “there is scarce an instance to be found of any opinion driven out of the world by persecution” which can be taken as a word of warning to the present government persecuting Covenanters and others. The option is to accept and tolerate such diverse Protestant fanatics – or kill them all; but the latter is not very Christian, Locke reminds his readers.

b. Other Political Writings

In 1669-70 Locke commented on Samuel Parker’s Discourse of Ecclesiastical Party (1669), which attacked Nonconformists or Dissenters. Shaftesbury sought a policy of toleration against the Anglican policy to unify the Kingdom under its brand of Protestantism. (The Anglican Church or Church of England was created by Henry VIII’s split from Rome – he became both head of state and head of the church, and the ruling monarch remains head of both state and church in England today. The Church of England, as its name suggests is a particular nationalist brand of Protestantism in which Bishops sit with Lords in the Upper Chamber of Parliament). Locke’s comments are worth noting for evidence of a further swing away from political conservativism adhering to establishment structures to a radicalism that seeks their containment in favour of inalienable individual rights. He now insists that government’s purpose is to secure the peace and not to get involved with the outward appearances of different interpretations of religion – he questions whether the policy of uniformity is conducive of peace (OSP); and here Locke presents a theory that he was to embellish on over the next decade in his denial that government can be said to stem from Adam’s descendants. This the theory Locke criticises of Sir Robert Filmer in the Two Treatises: if Adam was the first king, it is not the case that his descendants automatically gain the same right – “all government, monarchical or other, is only from the consent of the people.” (OSP)

Locke repeats the purpose of government of securing the peace and tranquillity of the commonwealth and stresses the separation of the Church and State in what can be seen as the glimmerings of his minimal state theory. “The end of civil society is civil peace and prosperity … but beyond the concernments of this life [i.e., religion], this society hath nothing to do at all.” (CEP) Since religion deals with the hereafter and the state the present, and the two jurisdictions should not mix.

Thus prior to the change of wind in the Two Treatises, Locke’s conservative, moral authoritarian philosophy is highly apparent in various comments throughout the 1670s and 80s. In Obligation of Penal Laws, for example, Locke scepticism of the government’s misuse of power is growing, but he still insists that the subject’s duty is to preserve a peaceful society and not to disturb or endanger his government and that, so long as a man’s conscience is free from political interference, he ought to obey the rules of his country. This, incidentally, is symptomatic of a mind-body dualism (as it affects the political realm), in which a philosopher asserts the primacy and hence freedom of the mind while accepting the subjugation of the body, a dichotomy that Locke only gradually moves away from.

By 1676, for instance, we again see evidence of a change in his thinking towards Protestant dissenters (Catholics standing outwith the Lockean picture). In his second essay on Toleration (Tb) in the year he expands on his critique of uniformity. He demands what a policy ought to be if all dissenters are in error – should they be all hanged? But if there is a fear of them is it because of the manner in which they are treated by the authorities, or if there is a fear that they may influence other people, then why not let others choose by their own consent to follow or not, or if it is feared that supporters of dissenting doctrines shall multiply, then either dissenters are attracting others because of the truth or orthodox teachers have become slack in propagating the truth. Since Christians are likely to fight over their sectarian differences, “to settle the peace of places where there are different opinions in religion, two things are to be perfectly distinguished: religion and government … and their provinces [ought] to be kept well distinct.” That is, the Church and the State should be kept thoroughly separate.

Yet Locke’s political rationalism – his disposition to impose a particular, ideal moral order on his nation – remains strong. In notes for his Atlantis (1676-79), he proposes stringent laws to deal with vagrants, demands that everyone work at their handicraft at least six hours a week, that limits be put on migration across parishes, and that tithingmen be put in control of assuring the moral purity of their jurisdiction (one tithingman to twenty homes). Each month the tithingman even ought to visit the houses of his tithing “to see what lives they lead.” (At). Public almshouses ought to be erected for those incapable of working, otherwise “all beggars shall ipso facto be taken and sent to the public workhouse and there remain for the rest of their lives.” (At).

Between 1677 and 1678 Locke scribbled thoughts on the springs of human action. “Happiness and misery are the two great springs,” he notes, but happiness in misery are both resoluble into pleasure and pain. Accordingly, Locke argues for a hedonistic, utilitarian basis for morality – a different direction from his earlier Oxford essays, but tempers the thrust of hedonism noting the importance that reputation plays in a man’s life, also calling reputation “the principle spring from which the actions of men take their rise …” (R) and were there no human laws – no positive legislation – “there’d still be such species of actions as justice, temperance and fortitude…” (R) for the laws of morality come from God and from nature.

Thus prior to the penning of the Two Treatises, we find a John Locke who is becoming increasingly concerned with the direction of Restoration policy with regards to religious toleration, and although he remains very conservative in his moral outlook, the formulation of a new approach is evidently developing. The government, he declares with a stronger and more influential voice, ought to remove itself from the religious matters of the nation. The separation of the state and religion is now paramount in his philosophy, all it needed was a structure within which such a minimal, non-interfering government could be justified. That was prompted by the publication of the late Sir Robert Filmer’s Patriarcha – a defence of divinely appointed and justified monarchy and absolutism.

c. Economic Writings

In the 1670s under Shaftesbury’s patronage, Locke expounded a mercantilist philosophy of trade and a hard-money policy.

The mercantilist Locke argues that the end of trade is “riches and power” – and trade increases a nation’s wealth and its people, producing a virtuous circle of economic improvement; yet, like most mercantilists, he condemns activity that are not conducive to economic growth – a theory that has seeped into present day tax codes and economic policy, although the characters targeted tend to change. For Locke anyone involved in the service industry hinders trade: retailers to some degree, lawyers, “but above all soldiers in pay.” The economic theory is suspicious, as is Locke’s assertion that one man’s gain is another man’s loss – an Aristotelian view of trade that has yet to be shaken from present day conceptions and which mercantilists support.

However, Locke also favoured a hard money policy to secure the value of a nation’s currency. It would be wrong to debase the coinage to match the number of notes that the Bank of England printed.

Some detect in Locke a ‘labour theory of value’ – the proposition that all economic values can be resolved into the amount and quality of labour imbued in them. Marxists, for example, assume Locke to have proposed a labour theory of value, whereas the libertarian economist, Murray Rothbard, argues that what Locke propounded was a labour theory of property, not of value. The sections to read are in Chapter V, and a close reading of the text suggests that Locke’s emphasis on the ability of labour to create value qua production, rather than value qua price. For elsewhere, Locke observes that the fair price (a term that has wended down through the ages from Aristotle) is that which is generated in a market on a particular occasion, tempered by notions of Christian charity to avoid gaining excess profits (leaving enough for others, as Locke advises for the enclosure of land). Labour – active productive labour, based on rationality and productivity – increases the wealth of the nation, it does not generate a system of fair prices.

5. Two Treatises

There is a scholarly debate on when the Two Treatises were written. They were first published in 1689, but when they were penned is of critical importance; originally the Two Treatises were deemed an apology – a defence – for the Glorious Revolution, but Peter Laslett claims its origins back to 1679, while Richard Ashcroft disagrees and places it in 1680-82, allowing Locke to make amendments to the manuscript to give the impression it acts as an apology for rather than a prescription of revolt; for readers interested in knowing more, I refer them to Laslett’s 1988 Cambridge Edition of the Two Treatises.

In opening the Two Treatises, diligence and perseverance pay off for the reader – and on a pedagogical note, I would recommend (following Laslett) beginning with the Second before the First Treatise. The reader ought to work through each chapter carefully, noting the main point or points in each section (denoted §) to follow Locke’s relatively convoluted sentences in pursuit of the main clause like Sherlock Holmes on a case, and revising what notes have been reaped before pressing on. Locke’s system is brilliant, and so we must read him, for hidden in the well-crafted arguments, we also find gems of thoughts and insights.

a. First Treatise

The First Treatise is a logical rebuttal of the works of Sir Robert Filmer whose Patriarcha and other writings supported the theory of the divine rights of kings – that is, monarchy is a divine established institution and that kings rule as God’s regents on earth. The First Treatise paves the way, as Locke advertises in his Preface, to justify government by the consent of the people. In this summary, I am not concerned with a scholastic checking of the validity of Locke’s examination of Filmer’s work (or of Locke’s own selective reading of the Bible – see Cox) but with summarising the essential points he presents.

Chapter I.
Locke summarises Filmer’s theory that all government is [or ought to be] an absolute monarchy: since Adam was an absolute monarch, all princes since his time should also be absolute monarchs. Secondly, since Filmer believes that no man is born free, men cannot [or should not be able to] choose their governors, thus government by consent is to be rejected on the epistemological grounds that the masses do not possess the intellectual wherewithal to elect their leaders.

“Slavery is so vile and miserable an Estate of Man,” begins the overture of Locke’s critique of Filmer’s system (§1). But a description of affairs under absolute monarchy does not in itself provide a justification of establishing government on popular consent, nor does the presumption that men would live in a miserable condition rebut the claim for absolutism. Accordingly, Locke proceeds to examine carefully Filmer’s assumptions and the logical cohesion of his arguments to refute the theory of divine rule before outlining, in the Second Treatise, his justification of consensual government (see below). Locke’s analysis of Filmer proceeds by drawing upon the essential assumptions or premises which Filmer presents.

Chapter II.
Filmer firstly (as we read Locke’s critique) claims that man is not born into freedom, because he is born to parents – and the right that the father naturally possesses is unlimited over the child’s life. However, Locke replies, Filmer does not give an account of this fatherly power – that is, Filmer assumes the father ought to possess unlimited power without providing a justification of that power, and since, according to Locke, Filmer’s assertion implies that humanity should be enslaved to a single ruler, it behoves his opponent to offer a justification. Nonetheless, as the First Treatise continues, Filmer is seen to have provided a justification, for Locke has to provide several arguments against Filmer’s attempts to provide a secure theoretical basis for patriarchy.

Chapter III.
Filmer secondly proposes that to assert man’s freedom is equivalent to denying the Biblical story of man’s assertion, a claim that Locke swiftly shows to be logically fallacious. Questioning the validity of the former does not imply a concurrent questioning of the latter.

Moreover, Locke demands why the fact of Adam’s creation should give him sovereignty over anything – that has to be established and not presumed. Locke thus queries Filmer’s conception of sovereignty: as first man and possessing no subjects, he could hardly be called a monarch. He is “a governor in habit rather than in act,” Filmer contends, to which Locke humorously replies: “A very pretty way of being a Governor without Government, a Father without Children, and a King without Subjects. And thus Sir Robert was an Author before he writ his Book …” (§18). In other words, potentiality does not imply actuality.

Locke presses the point – whence does Adam receive his power over others? By becoming a father, Filmer (thirdly) argues (and thereby provides a justification for his patriarchy). Locke reminds his readers that Filmer passes over the role of the mother in producing children and that in quoting from the Bible, Filmer drops any references to the mother: ‘honour thy father and thy mother’ becomes just ‘honour thy father’. Nonetheless, if Adam’s power comes from begetting children and becoming a father, then without children he was surely powerless, Locke concludes.

Chapter IV.
Perhaps Adam’s title, as understood by Filmer, was over the resources of the earth, that is, Adam was a proprietor rather than a monarch. No, Locke writes, quoting from the Scriptures, for God gave the earth to ‘them’, in other words to mankind as a whole and not to one particular individual. Nevertheless, Locke asks, even if Adam were given title over the earth’s resources, how does that give him political power over others’ lives?

Chapter V.

Filmer fourthly attempts to justify patriarchy by claiming that Eve was created to be subject to her husband, and thus forms the ‘Original Grant of Government’ whereas Locke retorts that a distinction must be made between her role as a wife and that of Adam’s power over her life, or that of any other. Firstly, Locke replies, since Adam sinned with Eve in the Garden of Eden, this hardly gives him a moral standing to rule others, and secondly, how does Eve’s matrimonial subjection to Adam entitle him to head a monarchical government? The two are separable issues, and Filmer, Locke notes, often deploys linguistic ambiguities in his terms to assert his theory without actually justifying it. Thirdly, if a man gains monarchical power by possessing a wife, then surely, Locke concludes, according to Filmer’s position there should be as many monarchs as there are husbands.

Chapter VI.
Filmer’s fifth attempt to claim Adam’s royal authority is based on the subjection of his children and this power should be supreme. This time, Filmer presents a justification: since the father gives life and being to a child he therefore possesses absolute power over him. Yet, Locke counters, firstly: if you give something to another, that does not mean that you have a right to take it back; secondly, Filmer ignores that life is given to us all by God, and adds that we know so little as to what produces a soul or breathes life into an entity that assuming it to be wholly the father is presumptuous; indeed and thirdly, what role in begetting a child does a man have except “the satisfying his present Appetite”? (§54) Fourthly, Locke notes the obvious and greater role a woman plays in producing a child. All these counterarguments undermine Filmer’s emphasis on male dominion and take Locke into very liberal territory (contemporarily speaking) of raising woman’s status, a view more consistent with the Puritans than Anglicans.

Filmer’s defence of his fifth point, as Locke reads him, is that the Ancients had absolute rights over their children, and Locke rightly rejoins that that does not mean present generations ought to – after all, the Ancients also practised incest, adultery, and sodomy, (§59), and presumably Filmer would not wish those to be re-established.

A parent may, arguably, alienate his rights over a child, Locke notes, but a child cannot alienate the honour due to his parent, an argument Filmer ignores. More pointedly, if a father possesses absolute rights over his children and that gives him political dominion too, then surely, echoing the logic of Chapter V, Locke complains that Filmer’s theory would all as many monarchs as there are fathers. Such political plurality would destroy all lawful governments in the world, which would contradict Filmer’s attempt to justify a stable political regime.

Chapter VII.
Switching to discuss the role of property in Filmer’s theory; if we allow Adam’s entitlement to the earth’s resources and that he wills it upon his eldest son, this does not necessarily mean that Adam’s power is also willed to the eldest son. The eldest son, Locke reasons, did not beget his brethren, and accordingly cannot be said to inherit his father’s power over them. Accordingly, power over resources and political power are distinguishable and should be treated as separate issues.

Chapter VIII.
Locke discovers that Filmer accepts that governmental power may be passed on by succession, grant, usurpation, and election, and that Filmer accepts that “it matters not by what Means [a king] came by it.” Filmer’s theory is thus full of contradiction, Locke contends. Although he would apparently discard Filmer’s theory at this point, Locke continues his logical critique of patriarchy.

Chapter IX.
If we are to have one ruler, we should know who that person is otherwise there would be no distinction between pirates and princes. How successful is Filmer in describing this? Filmer claims that Adam’s power did not end in him but was passed onto succeeding generations and that secondly, present princes and rulers are direct descendants of that power. If Filmer’s first argument fails, that is not too problematic, Locke notes, for another theory of government may be expounded; but if the second fails, that would “destroy the Authority of the present Governors, and absolve the People from Subjection to them.” (§83). It must therefore be shown how Adam’s power is passed on, otherwise we must assume his power died with him and was passed back to God: in other words, we must look to the origins of government (Locke thus sets the reader up for the Second Treatise) – if the formation of government was consensual, then that must also direct its descent [although why that must be the case is not established], or it was by divine donation then God must also give it to the successor, rather than presuming it passes to the eldest male. But certainly, power cannot be derived from the act of begetting, for the eldest did not beget his younger siblings nor could he inherit his father’s rights over his mother. Paternal power can not therefore be inherited and the power that is now in the world is not Adam’s. (§103).

Although power cannot be passed onto children, Locke also rejects the passing of property solely to the eldest – it must pass equally to all of his children as God gave the earth in common to all, but once a man has formed a property right over something, it is a law of nature that his property be passed on to his children: children have a title to share in the property of their parents, and for Locke, that entitlement is equal (§93). Locke’s rejection of primogeniture is also of interest here and reminds the reader of his unorthodox stance on several issues.

Incidentally, in this Chapter Locke outlines his own theory to act as a foil to Filmer’s attempted justification of patriarchy and primogeniture. God planted in man the drive to preserve himself; He made the earth’s resources available to him and directed man to use his reason and senses to exploit the earth and its creatures for his benefit, and government is established to preserve a man’s property from the violence of others.

Chapter X.
Filmer claims that wherever there is a multitude of people, there will be one who is the heir to Adam’s monarchical power. This implies, counters Locke, that there will be one king who presently rules over all the kings in power, which means that either this right of being Adam’s political descendant is not necessary to justify the power presently held by rulers, or that they are all unlawfully in power, and accordingly, the multitude has no need to conscientiously obey their governments – a conclusion that Filmer would surely wish to avoid, as well as one that Locke implies is unacceptable to his own theory of government.

Chapter XI.
So who should be the heir, Locke asks, if we continue with Filmer’s exposition and accept that Adam’s power descended from him? After all, we are not questioning whether there ought to be government (Power) but who should be in power (§106). Filmer claims sovereignty to pass through Adam’s lineage – but who is not of that lineage, Locke asks. If it is the eldest son, Scriptural evidence contradicts Filmer’s theory, and what happens if there is not a son, or that son is a fool? With such a convoluted theory, surely God would have given us indications as to his meaning, after all, Locke adds, Scripture tells us whom we can and cannot marry.

Filmer offers several descriptions of Biblical characters possessing power, but Locke disallows them all. Firstly, Filmer says evidence of patriarchy is that the ruler possessed the power of death over people – to which Locke replies, anyone may have that power. Secondly, the ruler possessed the power to raise and army and to make war – to which Locke replies, as can any commonwealth, or indeed, any individual can also possess that power, implying that the power to wage war is independent of sovereignty and is merely attached to the ability to raise an army. And if power can be gained by attacking and conquering others, then Filmer’s attempt at securing sovereignty through the line of Adam fails. Nonetheless, Locke argues that contrary to patriarchal forms of government, God’s chosen people were often leaderless and lived in commonwealths – and what, he asks, happened to their form of government when they suffered centuries of bondage? Where was the rightful heir to Adam’s power during that period? Looking over the judges that were raised to power, whom Locke sees as being consensually appointed, he finds childless men and one woman – continuing evidence against Filmer’s assertion that power descended linearly through Adam’s descendants.

The rejection of the divine right theory of monarchy and of absolutism now complete, Locke turns his attention to outlining and justifying his own conception of government and the rights of citizens. It is one of the greatest texts in political philosophy and deserves a close reading.

b. Second Treatise

Chapter I.
Locke now sets out his own theory of political power in which he will look at the power of the magistrate as distinct from the power a parent wields over children or employers over employees (“a Master over his Servant”) or conjugal power (“a Husband over his Wife”). He defines political power as the power of making laws and executing penalties, the preservation of property, and of employing the force of the community in executing the laws and defending the commonwealth from foreign attack. Power, he stresses, must only be used for the public good.

Chapter II.
Locke outlines his theoretical construction of the state of nature. Given God gave the earth to all of mankind, Locke envisages the state of nature as a state of perfect equality in which each person has the freedom to do as he sees fit without asking leave or depending on the will of any other man. Reason teaches man not to harm his neighbour or his liberty or possessions, but also that he is right to punish those who transgress against him. “The State of Nature has a Law of Nature to govern it, which obliges everyone”, and “there cannot be supposed any such Subordination among us, that may Authorize us to destroy one another.” (§6). Indeed, aggressors – those who violate the freedom of others – live life by another (implicatively unnatural) standard, one that is irrational and thus dangerous. If a man is attacked by another, he is fully justified in punishing the offender and being the “Executioner of the Law of Nature” (§8) to kill murderers and seek reparation from thieves. It is better for a man to judge his own case than to have “one Man commanding a multitude, has the Liberty to be Judge in his own Case, and may do to al his Subjects whatever he pleases” (§13). So far has Locke moved away from his conservative Oxford days of erring on the side of magistrates.

The state of nature is not just a theoretical conception, for wherever there is a lack of government or arbitrating institutions between men or nations, the state of nature presides. “For ’tis not every Compact that puts an end to the State of Nature between men.” (§14).

Chapter III.
Whenever a man “declaring by Word or Action, not a passionate and hasty, but a sedate settled Design upon another Mans life, [he puts] him a State of War.” That is, the breach of peace is the declaration of war, and accordingly a man has the natural right to defend himself against aggressors who renounce reason and who live like predators. Where there is no common power, any use of force takes man back to the state of nature and this continues until a common magistrate is set up; but where proper government is lacking, a man’s actions are to be judged by his conscience alone. But the state of nature is distinguishable from the state of war, a dissimilarity Locke criticises followers of Thomas Hobbes for not making. The state of nature is governed by peace, goodwill, preservation, and mutual assistance, whereas the state of war is a condition of enmity, malice, violence, and mutual destruction.

To avoid the costs (the “inconveniences”) associated with the state of nature – of being without a common power to ensure the rule of law and order – men are disposed to join a society.

Chapter IV.
Locke presents his rejection of slavery: man’s liberty in society is to be under no other legislative power but that established by consent and under no other will or power but what the legislative enacts according to the trust put in it. Slavery is defined as being under absolute, arbitrary, and despotic power, and, we may recall from Chapter I of the First Treatise, it is the most miserable condition of man – yet it is not wholly unjustifiable in Locke’s system; if a man aggresses against another, he loses all rights in the just war fought against his aggression, and thus may he be rightly enslaved. (Incidentally, Locke deemed the West Africans enslaved by the Royal Africa Company to have been taken prisoners in a just war against them, thus defending, if somewhat naively, colonial slavery).

Locke rebuffs the argument that a man can enslave himself to another, because, ultimately, he may take his own life and by so regaining his freedom thus deprives the slave master of his power. This puts a terminal limit on a master’s power over his charges. Freedom, Locke notes in passing, is not something to do as one pleases, as Sir Robert Filmer [and many since] would describe it in order to reject it (that is, a straw man fallacy).

Chapter V.
With regards to property, Locke recalls his earlier argument that the earth is initially given to all in common, but most importantly for Lockean political theory he argues that “every man has a Property in his own Person.” (§27). Therefore, when he moves away from the state of nature, whatever he mixes his labour with becomes his property, with the proviso that “at least where there is enough, and as good left in common for others.” (§27). Although God gave the earth in common, He did not mean it to remain in common and uncultivated, for “He gave it to the use of the Industrious and Rational.” (§34). The expansion of private property also increases the net yield to the commonwealth (that is, causes economic growth – something Adam Smith was to later develop). Private property also clarifies resource ownership and thus removes areas of contention.

When a man mixes his labour with anything and by drawing it into his private ownership, he makes it more valuable. The benefits of private ownership can be readily compared to those nations in which few people reside upon commonly owned tracts. Ownership gives a man an entitlement to do with his resources as he pleases, although in this chapter, Locke is ready to remind his readers of the duty they bear to others, for those who waste their (non-durable) resources “rob others” of the benefits they could have produced for the community; but apart from that, a man may acquire wealth justly.

Chapter VI.
In discussing paternal power, Locke proclaims that children are under their parents’ rule until maturity, but, in comparison with Filmer, who claimed that no men can be free because of the subjection to their parents, Locke asserts that the development of a man’s reason frees him from their protection. To turn children out of the home before their reason has developed sufficiently is to throw them out amongst the beasts and into a wretched state. Once they are mature enough, children have the ability and hence the right to choose what society they wish to belong to; accordingly, Locke emphasises that parental power should not be confused with political power.

Chapter VII.
God drives men into society, Locke notes, deploying the traditional Aristotelian thesis that society stems from sexual desire, reproduction, and then employment (that is, man and woman come together, they reproduce, and employ servants – and gain slaves captured in just wars), a thesis that was repeated throughout the ages but more recently, in Locke’s time, being advanced by, for example, by Hugo Grotius and Pufendorf. Incidentally, Locke notes that a wife has a right to leave her husband (§82).

The society that develops from conjugal and kinship origins tends to posses commonly established laws and a judicature, as well as an adjudicating authority. All men are equal before the law, including those passing legislation. The created commonwealth then possesses the power, a power delegated to it by the citizens, to punish transgressors and external aggressors and to protect the property of its members. In removing themselves from the state of nature, men hand over the power to punish to the executive; but where the process of appeal is lacking, men remain – or at least their social relations remain – in the state of nature. When their property is not safe, then people cannot think themselves as being in a civil society.

The move towards a civil, law-abiding society, also shows why absolute monarchy is inconsistent with that society: “to think that Men are so foolish that they take care to avoid what mischiefs may be done them by Pole-Cats, or Foxes, but are content, nay think it Safety, to be devoured by Lions.” (The lion being the traditional symbol of kingship).

Chapter VIII
This chapter continues with the origins of political society. Community begins with consent, Locke argues, and this consent can only be majority consent, as universal consent is impossible to gain. Consent of the governed is the only justifiable form of government, but of course critics are going to ask for evidence for consensual government. Locke replies that the lack of evidence does not imply that early governments were not formed consensually, but because people were initially equal in the state of nature, it can be deduced that they consented to put rulers over and above them.

Indeed, Locke accepts that people historically converged onto monarchical forms of government, for he agrees that it would make sense to put political power into the hands of those they trusted or who were capable of ensuring the rule of peace; certainly such a government would reflect the natural disposition to look up to a male patriarch, but Locke is not bowing down to Filmer’s theoretical proposition that all government should be monarchical. Any power given to the government was given to secure the public good and safety and the defence of immature societies from external aggression, but once the legislators or executors of the law sought to use power for their own interests then it becomes vital for men to understand the origins of government and the limitations to its power, so that they may find methods to prevent such abuses of power.

A people are free to remove themselves from their government – that is, they are free to secede and to establish a new commonwealth if they see fit, for only an explicit promise or contract can put man into a society and, just as children upon reaching maturity are free to leave their parents, so too are men free to leave their society.

Chapter IX
Locke raises the question as to why a man may give up his freedom that he enjoys in the state of nature. He answers because that state is full of uncertainty and it is also exposed to aggression. The state of nature lacks established, known and settled laws, a known and indifferent judge, and the power to give a judge execution of the law. In the state of nature man has two powers – to preserve himself according to the Law of Nature and the power to punish criminals. In such a free state, all men are of one community making up a society distinct from the animals. “And were it not for the corruption, and vitiousness of degenerate Men, there would be no need of any other; no necessity that Men should separate from this great and natural Community, and by positive agreements combine into smaller and divided associations.” (§128) In other words, the few who seek to predate and to live by force, prompt people to form polities.

In joining a society, man gives up his power to protect himself to the laws of his society; he also gives up the power of punishing aggressors, and they do this “only with an intention in every one the better to preserve himself his Liberty and Property.” (§131). It could not be supposed that we would join a society to be made worse off.

Chapter X
What form a government takes depends on where the supreme (legislative) power is located.

Chapter XI
Legislative power is supreme but it ought not to be absolute or arbitrary. What power it should wield is limited to the powers that man possessed in the state of nature which should also be limited to serving the public good. It “can never have a right to destroy, enslave, or designedly impoverish the subjects.” (§135) Its laws must thus conform to the laws of nature and any use of arbitrary or absolute power, or indeed, operating without settled law, creates a situation worse than the state of nature. “For then Mankind will be in a far worse condition, than in the State of Nature, if they shall have armed one or a few Men with the joynt power of a Multitude. (§137).

The government cannot take a man’s property without his consent, and since governments need to raise taxes to finance themselves, they can only do so with the consent of the governed. “Hence it is a mistake to think, that the Supream or Legislative Power of any Commonwealth, can do what it will, and dispose of the Estates of the Subject arbitrarily, or take any part of them at pleasure.” (§137) The tendency of politicians is to think “themselves to have a distinct interest, from the rest of the Community; and so will apt to increase their own Riches and Power, by taking, what they think fit, from the People.” (§137) This last is a powerful statement, both of Locke’s cynical conception of power and the legitimate boundaries based on natural law that he envisages for governments.

Chapter XII
There is no need for the legislative to stand all the time (and in the following chapter Locke observes that if it meets frequently it can become dangerous or at least burdensome), but the executive power ought to be permanently in office to ensure that the laws are enforced.

Chapter XIII
The people have the right to alter the legislative; similarly, if the executive stops the legislative from sitting, it effectively declares war on the people (§155). Executive power is held wholly on trust and representation in the legislative should be equal (§157).

Chapter XIV
The executive may use powers of prerogative to ensure the smooth process of legislation, but it ought never to overstep its bounds. Locke observes that while good princes stay within their limitations, “the reigns of good princes have always been most dangerous to the liberties of their people” for developing a trust in their prerogative which is soon abused by the next generation.

Chapter XV.
Since nature does not give one man power over another, as all men are equal, that power can only be gained over those who wage unjust war upon the peaceful commonwealth. The aggressor forfeits his rights, for he acts like the beasts that society is formed to protect people from and therefore “renders himself liable to be destroied by the injur’d person and the rest of mankind, that will joyn with him in the execution of Justice.” (§172)

Chapter XVI.
Human history is certainly of war and conquest, however “many have mistaken the force of Arms, for the consent of the People … But Conquest is as far from setting up any Government as demolishing an House is from building a new one in the place … but, without the Consent of the people, can never erect a new one.” (§176) Aggressors in an unjust war cannot have rights over the conquered people; on the other hand, in fighting a just war, power can only be justifiably held over those who fought and not the innocents who did not partake in the fighting. Locke thus establishes strict just war code, strictly demarcating non-combatants from combatants, and also the property of conquered combatants and their dependents. “Conquerors, ’tis true, seldom trouble themselves to make the distinction, but they willingly permit the confusion of War to sweep altogether; but yet this alters not the Right.” (§179).

Chapter XVII.
In a note on usurpation, Locke apparently accepts the usurpation of power by another personality; it only becomes problematic when the usurper adds to his power.

Chapter XVIII.
Accordingly, tyranny is the exercise of power beyond normal rights; no one can have a right to that power and an unjust regime may thusly be opposed. “Tyranny is the exercise of Power beyond Right, which no Body can have a Right to.” (§199) If the laws do not protect me, I have a right to defend myself. “May the Commands then of a Prince be opposed?” Yes, when the Prince deploys unjust force (§204).

Chapter XIX.
A government is thus dissolved if it falls to a foreign power or if there is a civil war, when the government acts illegally or refuses the legislative to sit, or acts contrary to the trust put in it by the people. A people should not wait until the chains are put on them before they rebel.

6. Analysis of Locke’s Two Treatises

In this section, the reader’s attention is drawn to several issues that the Two Treatises raises. It is by no means exhaustive, indeed it is extremely fractional in comparison with the debates and problems the Two Treatises have provoked. Lockean scholarship has attracted and continues to generate hundreds of articles on the various aspects of his philosophy – property, rights, rebellion, women, trust, social contract theory, anarchy, toleration, etc., and here I can only touch on a few. References are to sections (§) within the Second Treatise unless noted.

a. State of Nature

Locke’s state of nature is often contrasted with that of Thomas Hobbes’s, with which he would have had some familiarity either through reading Hobbes’s Leviathan or Pufendorf’s critique of Hobbes. Hobbes’s vision of a world without government is one of a war of all against in all, in which each will seek to aggress opportunistically against his neighbour – violence and resulting fear are endemic to life in a world without political power. At §19, Locke compares his own vision with Hobbes’s, arguing that Hobbes has not distinguished between the state of nature and the state war. Nonetheless, Locke’s vision remains tainted with the fear of neighbourly mistrust and Hobbesian elements: rather than the majority being so disposed to violence or fraud, in Locke it is the “inconveniences” brought about by a minority that the majority seek to defend themselves against.

On the whole, Locke’s anarchic state of nature is a benevolent condition of anarchic individualism, rather than Hobbesian brutality and mutual suspicion, in which conscience guides actions and reason (reflecting the law of nature) highlights the wrongness and counter-productivity of aggressing against one’s neighbour. Those who do aggress thereby renounce their humanity and act worse than beasts and may justly be harshly dealt with.

So why leave this idyllic state? Locke falls back on the fears of his time – the absence of power produces “inconveniences” and the fear of civil tumult, and where there is no common set of laws and impartial adjudicators, the advantages of “perfect freedom and equality” are offset by the worries of aggression. Three inconveniences arise: a lack of knowledge of known laws, which creates informational costs involved in action if agents do not know, or disagree on, the particularities of the laws of nature that legislation seeks to reflect; secondly, the absence of power to execute laws, and hence the vulnerability of small groups or individuals being violated by aggressive, more numerous groups; thirdly, in the state of nature, the agent judges his own case and for Locke, people can not be trusted to judge impartially and hence require a government to adjudicate.

There are problems with each of these. Firstly, the lack of known laws does not stop agents from working together to produce a common framework without the state. The Law Merchant is a good example and could have been known to Locke – merchants trading across different governmental jurisdictions often find national laws highly awkward or inconsistent, so they seek their own forms of international law – independent of any political power. Secondly, a lack of executive power in the state of nature does not warrant a monopolisation of power, just as, on Lockean reasoning, the lack of property ownership does not warrant a government monopoly in property – an argument Locke rejected in Filmer’s Patriarcha. As private ownership develops, so too does the breadth of the services offered, and just as one family does not have to produce all of the goods they desire (bread, shelter, clothing), so it does not need to produce security services. Thirdly, while individuals may disagree on what may be the particularities of the law in a case of conflict of interests, it does not imply that all individuals will agree to accept the same arbitrator, i.e., put all adjudication services into the same hands or institution. In fact, by handing over arbitration to a single institution logically invalidates the reason for seeking arbitration – if the state possesses a monopoly on adjudication services, then to whom should individuals turn for arbitrating between the state and themselves? Locke is aware of the failure of governmental adjudication, for in §20, he recognises that “where an appeal to the Law … lies open, but the remedy is deny’d by a manifest perverting of Justice, … there it is hard to imagine any thing but a State of War. For wherever violence is used, and injury done, though by hands appointed to administer Justice, it is still violence and injury, however colour’d with the Name, Pretences, or Forms of Law…” But rather than counselling rebellion and a rejection of the only system of appeals a state offers, Locke shrugs and reminds his readers that “the only remedy in such Cases [is] an appeal to Heaven.”

What Locke does not consider is a world without political power – just as Filmer assumed that Adam’s creation gave him monarchical power and proprietorship over the world, so too Locke makes the same logical leap into accepting the need for power, and his reasons for justifying it – the three inconveniences – are as subject to criticism as Filmer’s justification of Adam’s power in the fact of his begetting children. Similarly, the free and equal society of the state of nature is arguably not rendered more efficient by consenting to be ruled by a single, albeit limited, power. Locke’s comment on the reign of good princes shows good perception – if the state appears to work efficiently, then it is more disposed to expanding its goodly services and thereby weakening or even destroying the very reason for its formation.

b. Reason and Violence

Reason teaches the maturing individual to respect others’ rights to their freedom and the extent to which an aggressor ought to be punished – “so far as reason and conscience dictate” (§8). Just as we have seen in his other writings, Locke’s moral absolutism and even Old Testament ethic resurface – murderers (§12) and thieves (§18) deserve death, for a man has a right to destroy that which threatens his life.

However, in §16, Locke’s definition of war, that it arises when declared by word or action and not a “hasty” or a “passionate” action – suggests that a crime de passion may be forgivable, yet it also raises the possibility that a declared act of war could be a very reasonable option for an aggressor; yet Locke insists that aggressors have, by the fact of initiating force, renounced reason, despite the implication of a cold and calculating, “sedate settled Design.” It is an apparent inconsistency which requires deeper consideration, for aggressors cannot be both lower than beasts, who are motivated by their appetite say, and be simultaneously of such a calculating mentality. At some point, a man’s reason could be said to bifurcate, with one branch producing rationalisations – excuses for initiating violence – and the other branch reflecting the laws of nature that man is free and must logically accept his neighbour’s right to be free and to live without interference.

An aggressor seeks to gain absolute control over the individual – over his life and his property, that is, he seeks to enslave him. Nothing, for Locke, can justify such a motive for that would “take away the Freedom, that belongs to any one in that State [of Nature].” (§17). Locke’s logical development of the framework is excellent – individuals possess the right of retaliation and defence against aggressors, who, by initiating force, thereby introduce a state of war, an unjustifiable condition of violence and inequality that leads to enslavement. But can a man be said to lose his rights if he aggresses against another? Hobbes was of the opinion that a man possessed an inalienable right to self-preservation, such that if he were to be executed (justly for murder say) he would still possess the right to flee. Locke’s asymmetrical conception of moral status presents problems that begin with the termination of an inalienable right to life.

This leads to Locke’s exposition of the nature of a just war.

c. Just War

Lockean war is judged primarily on the objective distinction between aggressor and defender: aggressors act without justice and defenders act with justice. But it should be noted that it is a necessary, but not sufficient, condition of Lockean just war that a party has been attacked. For although the initiation of force provides the objective criterion that distinguishes just from unjust acts, it is not a sufficient condition that may sustain a protracted defence of a country once it has fallen. Locke counsels patience (and prayer) for a defending side that has lost a just war.

But when the violence is over, both sides may subject themselves to “the fair determination of the Law” and agree to the appropriate conditions of reparation and penalty and deterrence from further aggression, but where no adjudicating body exists, then the state of war continues (§20). This may be read as a very Hobbesian view of international affairs, which is a popular conception (cf. Political Realism) that sees the lack of, or ineffectiveness of international bodies, as evidence of a presiding anarchy between nations – even in the absence of actual war, such a situation is still, on Lockean and Hobbesian reasoning characteristic of the state of nature.

The aggressor forfeits his own life and rights when he initiates force (§172) and sets up the rule of force as his standard. The defenders – the prosecutors of a just war – thus gain arbitrary and despotic power over soldiers captured in a just war. How long should such a right last for? Locke’s presumption of guilt suggests that a war crime (participating in an unjust war being sufficient) lasts for the lifetime of the soldier, which raises the question of forgiveness and amnesties and their applicability in Locke’s system. If we look at it from the position of victorious aggressors in an unjust war, Locke is adamant that they can “never come to have a right over the Conquered.” This surely implies that the guilty can never lose their guilt.

Whether a government or a villain commits aggression does not make any difference, Locke echoes the words of the philosophers reaching back through Aquinas, Augustine, and to Cicero. Yet what ought the unjustly defeated do? Remain patient, Locke counsels. Without proper redress against either a petty villain or an aggressive government, the citizen ought to persevere, for justice remains with God and aggressors will ultimately be judged there. Nonetheless, in the meantime, the conquerors in an unjust war have no title to the subjection and obedience of the conquered. Apparently, Locke again retreats to a Hobbesian position here – that the security of peace is to be preferred to the violence, uncertainty, and fears of war. Yet the defeated are entitled to survive – outward obedience to the regime may certainly be coupled with an inward conscientious disobedience. Anything extorted or taken from an individual by force, including promises and consent to obey, do not mean anything (§186). The shaking off an unjust force or rebellion against such masters “is no Offence before God” (§196).

On the other hand, the conquerors in a just war gain absolute power over those who raised arms against them in the first place – but there is no collective retribution permitted in Locke’s system. Those who did not fight – innocents, or in today’s parlance, non-combatants – do not lose any rights to the just conquerors. There must, accordingly, be a strict distinction between combatants and non-combatants, which reflects the just war conventions, but, as Locke admits, rarely in the history of war, conquerors “willingly permit[ting] the confusion of War to sweep altogether.” (§178-9) The right over the aggressors is perfectly despotic – that is, they may justly be put to death or enslaved, but that right does not extend to their property, for that property must also support the lives of those who did not bear arms. The conqueror has a right to reparation payments to “repair the damages he has sustained by the War”, but not beyond the aggressor’s estates, for that it would be robbery on the defender’s side to take more than that which covers his cost of war or to impose on the property of those who did not fight, such as his wife and children.

Self-defence against individuals or against states that infringe upon the fundament right to life, liberty, and property justifies defence. So to what extent can the Lockean state expand its jurisdiction? While its remit is ostensibly minimal or libertarian, other elements in Locke’s thinking suggest there are loopholes that may deemed utilitarian.

d. The Lockean State

The Lockean state is commissioned by a people to serve their interests in securing their rights to live peacefully. It opposes the organic Aristotelian conception of the state that perceives the state as the natural result of social growth – a development Locke agrees with but rejects the non-consensual characteristic of the Aristotelian state. The organic conception of the state collectivises the citizenry into a single body (a family ruled by the fatherly head as Filmer would perceive it), and thereby permits wielding the masses into directions the rulers see fit – ensuring that the collective as a whole survives and flourishes. We have seen that Locke’s conception of the state moves away from that of the ship and captain analogy to conceiving the state as an instrument whose sole purpose is to provide a secure framework for the life, property, and liberty of the people.

The organic conception is antithetical to the Lockean order. For Locke, government is no more than a tool that continuously depends on the consent of the people and must not violate the maximum conditions of securing peace and property – to do so is to violate the trust that is afforded the institution. It possesses no mystical nature of either a divine or a supernatural order, it is a mere prudential institution that can efficiently and effectively provide a better security service (though that is highly debatable – see above) than individuals working along in the natural state of freedom.

Political power is the power that every man in the state of nature possesses but which is given over to the society that they form: i.e., to the government set up to create an established and known set of laws, to arbitrate in disputes, and to preserve the life and property of its members. Locke’s vision is thusly of a minimal state whose justification can only be that of consent (§176). The state must not possess arbitrary, absolute powers over the lives and property of the civilians, yet its mandate must seek the public good and be democratic (that is, majority rule). This opens up issues.

First, historically, as Locke notes, “this Consent is little taken notice of: And therefore many have mistaken the force of Arms, for the consent of the people,” (§175). This does not undermine the theoretical justification of government – that it ought to be consensual, for earlier Locke stresses that adults have the right to secede from their present society to form a new one, therefore present occupation or de facto rule does not validate a government’s status. However, it does raise wonderfully intricate problems for any incumbent regime that oversteps its boundaries and initiates force against the people it is supposedly seeking to protect. It also tends to undermine the legitimacy of any regime not founded on consensual origins, as well as raises the question of how continual that consensus ought to be: should each generation renew its contract with its government body, and if it didn’t would that not undermine any legitimacy the government possessed? Or should implied consensus be an acceptable criterion of continual legitimisation of government – namely, the fact that a people do not seek to secede to migrate should be held as evidence of continued trust in their state?

Secondly, once government is justified, Locke’s particular political ethics demand that some people should not be part of the Commonwealth at all – Roman Catholics, atheists, and extreme religious sects should not be tolerated. Vagabonds and beggars are to be outlawed and pressed into government service (army or navy), and accordingly Locke argued for severe measures that would curtail a man’s freedom of movement, but what would the status of say, Roman Catholics, be in a Lockean state? If we take John Locke’s view – which was typical of many Protestant thinkers at the time (and indeed for the next hundred years) Catholics would be barred from enfranchisement – prohibited from attending political meetings or taking part in the political process; but if, on the other hand, we take the Lockean theory of the state and remove what can arguably considered as the incidental prejudices of the man and his time, then it is much more difficult to sustain a strong denial of freedom to those who would be intolerant of freedom. If a man’s conscience is to be free from interference, then so too must his freedom to express himself on his own land, say. The argument develops accordingly: may I possess the right to espouse treason in my own home, but not as a member of a public body? Or is it more the case that I can express what theories I care to, as long as the consequences of those speeches do not undermine the peaceful and Commonwealth? Locke remained intolerant of those who would overthrow a peaceful settlement, but that demands we look closer at the nature of peaceful settlements. The Glorious Revolution was bloodless in England, but not in Scotland or Ireland, and the inhabitants there saw the accession of William III through different eyes to their English contemporaries. Nevertheless, Lockean theory implies that we seek out objective distinctions rather than subjectively held differences – does the new regime uphold peace, property, and liberty, or does it strain to abuse power for its own ends. That remains the deciding argument for the Lockean, even though the details may be difficult to ascertain in practice.

e. Property

Much of Locke’s thesis depends on the status of property – that a man initially owns himself and then owns that with which he mixes his labour. It is a powerful theory and one that goes a long way in justifying private property both on utilitarian grounds that it creates wealth and on moral grounds. The Lockean conception of the state, as we have seen above, depends greatly on the role of property – the relationship between the two topics being difficult to disentangle. But let’s look more closely at what Locke says about property and some of the issues that arise.

In the state of nature, everything is commonly owned; but as God gave man senses and reason to use for his preservation and reproduction, that which he removes out of the state of nature with his own hands becomes his property – and this is natural and just. The fact that a man labours to pick fruit or till the soil presents the distinguishing characteristic of private versus commonly held property. There is no need for any consent to be given by his comrades living in the state of nature, indeed awaiting that consent may mean he starves! (§28). “The labour that was mine, removing them out of that common state they were in, hath fixed my Property in them.”

But take a river from which a man draws water. The water in his pitcher is necessarily his – by virtue of his labouring to retrieve it; however, the water remains in common ownership. Any game in the wild is owned by all, until the hunter marks it for the chase, upon which the hare or the deer begins to become his property (§30). Locke deals with the first objection that if a man, with his labour, manages to secure vast resources, but there are brakes on such an engrossment.

Firstly, Christian morality demands that a man take from nature that which is for his enjoyment, “as much as any one can make use of to any advantage of life before it spoils … whatever is beyond this, is more than his share, and belongs to others. Nothing was made by God for Man to spoil or destroy.” (§31). While human population was small, there was of course enough resources to go around, but with the increase in numbers, pressures are put on Locke’s proviso (ably examined in Robert Nozick’s Anarchy, State, and Utopia) that enough be left for others. While in England further enclosures would require the “consent of Fellow-Commoners”; nevertheless, enough vacant land was available to permit a doubling of the population and still permit enough to left over for others if every man sought to make use. Arguably, against present (21stC) misconceptions of man’s imprint on the globe, most of the earth is relatively under-populated by humans, yet governments have created severe barriers to the free migration of peoples to under-populated (and high wage) lands, something the Lockean would reject as abrogating the common land into the government’s hands yet not dispersing it to those who would (or actually do) mix their labour with it. Indeed, Locke favoured free migration as the quickest means to increase a nation’s wealth through the ensuing expansion of trade and markets. “You may therefore safely open your doors, and a freedom to them to settle here being secure of this advantage that you have the profit of all their labour …” (FGN).

As men settle down, Locke continues, they needed to delineate their titles to the land, a pressure that gathers as a population increases. Nonetheless, in the early state of ownership, a man’s title to the land depends on his continual cultivation of it (§38). If he lets his grass rot, or his fruit perish, then his enclosure reverts back to wasteland – i.e., common ownership, and hence to be available for another to cultivate. But once land is taken under private ownership, its productivity increases and a man can sell its surplus; in turn, economic growth causes a population to grow, and thereby the value of cultivated land increases. The introduction of money also permits a man to hold his profit in the form of coin, which does not waste, and thereby enables him (justly) to increase his wealth. The advance of private property, tempered with Christian charitable considerations, is inherently virtuous. But should the advancement resulting from enclosure be encouraged or even forced?

Some, for example, may read in Locke the right to take commonly held, uncultivated lands off the peoples that reside on them and who yet do not exploit them well, and certainly there is evidence that Locke would support such an enterprise (§45: “there are still great tracts of Land to be found which (the Inhabitants thereof not having joyned with the rest of Mankind, in the consent of the Use of their common Money) lie waste, and are more than the People, who dwell on it, do, or can make use of, and so still lie in common.” As an applied example of this Lockean problem, we may refer to an enterprise that forged the westward expansion of the United States. The fact that much of Indian territory was uncultivated could, on Lockean, grounds justify Abraham Lincoln’s Homestead Act of 1862 promoting the mixing of “Industrious and Rational” labour with the land to promote settlement, the expansion of the commonwealth and economic growth, for the “taking of this or that part, does not depend on the express consent of all the Commoners” (§28); alternatively, it could equally support the 1763 Proclamation of King George III accepting the land rights of the native Indians and prohibiting further European settlement of their land.

The initial Northwest Ordinance (1787) stipulated in very Lockean language, “The utmost good faith shall always be observed toward the Indians, their lands and property shall never be taken from them without their consent; and in their property, rights, and liberty, they shall never be invaded or disturbed, unless in just and lawful wars authorized by congress; but laws founded in justice and humanity shall from time to time be made, for preventing wrongs being done to them, and for preserving peace and friendship with them.” However, between 1830 and 1870 the US Government pushed for a policy of annexation and enforced migration that is far removed from anything John Locke would have condoned, but which has left Lockean scholars debating the nature and extent of the injustice perpetrated and the potential reparations due, a debate that gained momentum in the 1960s and which, in academic circles, now extends to other parts of the world in which unjust aggression has caused a population displacement or violation of a people.

From a standard reading of Locke, his theory supports the right of the original inhabitants’ entitlement of their land. “the Inhabitants of any Countrey [sic], who are descended, and derive a Title to their Estates from those, who are subdued, and had a Government forced upon them against their free consents, retain a Right to the Possession of their Ancestors, though they consent not freely to the Government, whose hard Conditions were by force imposed on the Possessors of that Country.” Since much of human history involves conquest, the extent of lands held unjustly are vast and the application of Lockean theory to explore potential solutions becomes consequently cumbersome. To what period of time can the original settlers of a land refer back to in establishing their primary proprietorship?

In the immediate aftermath of Locke’s publication of the Two Treatises his friend and Member of the Irish Parliament, William Molyneux, published The Case of Ireland, a defence of Irish nationalism in the face of British control. Locke refused to admit he had written the Two Treatises to Molyneux, who came to stay with Locke. Nothing is known of their conversation, but Molyneux’s work echoed the principles of the Two Treatises, but the House of Lords took umbrage and had the book burned. It is unclear what Locke’s response would have been, for Molyneux’s argument logically included the native Catholic population (as well as its Protestants) in the right to run Ireland. As Dunn notes, Locke may have favoured Catholic rule for Catholic nations far from the British Isles, but he could not approve of Catholic rule within the British jurisdiction. Molyneux’s Lockean arguments seeped through to the North American colonies and to Otis and Jefferson and eventually culminated in the American Revolution.

7. References and Further Reading

This article touches on the main political issues that emanate from Locke’s writings. It is highly advisable for the student to return again and again to Locke’s original works, where the depth and breadth of the philosopher’s thoughts can be better appreciated. The library of secondary literature (books and journals) is immense and growing – Locke has certainly has had an effective impact on political philosophy and new readers of his works can always add something to Lockean scholarship.

Locke, John. Two Treatises of Government. Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought. Ed. Peter Laslett. CUP: Cambridge, 1997.
Locke, John. Political Writings. Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought.Ed. Mark Goldie. CUP: Cambridge, 2002.
Locke, John. “Two Tracts on Government.” In Political Writings. Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought. Ed. Mark Goldie. CUP: Cambridge, 2002.
Locke, John. “Essay on the Law of Nature.” In Political Writings. Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought. Ed. Mark Goldie. CUP: Cambridge, 2002.

a. Abbreviations used

At: Atlantis, in Political Writings.
CEP: Civil and Ecclesiastical Power in Political Writings
EPL: Essay on the Poor Law in Political Writings
FCC: Fundamental Constitution of Carolina (*) in Political Writings
FGN: For a General Naturalisation (1693), in Political Writings.
FT: First Tract on Government (also known as the English Tract), in Political Writings.
OSP: On Samuel Parker (1669-70), in Political Writings
R: Reputation (1678) in Political Writings
Tb: Toleration B (1676) in Political Writings
V: Verses on Cromwell and King Charles II’s Restoration, in Political Writings.

b. Secondary Sources

Aaron, Richard I. John Locke. Encyclopedia Britannica. CD-ROM, 2001.
Copleston, Frederick. A History of Philosophy: Volume V. Image Books, New York, 1994.
Cox, R.H. Locke on War and Peace. OUP: Oxford, 1960.
Dunn, John. John: A Very Short Introduction. OUP: Oxford, 2003.
Harris, Ian. The Mind of John Locke. CUP: Cambridge, 1994. An excellent contextual analysis of the political and religious mindset of Locke’s Britain.
Laslett, Peter. “Introduction.” In Two Treatises of Government. CUP: Cambridge, 1997, pp.3-133.

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Alexander Moseley
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Moral Epistemology

Can we ever know that it’s wrong to torture innocent children? More generally, can we ever know, or at least have some justification for believing, whether anything is morally right or wrong, just or unjust, virtuous or vicious, noble or base, good or bad? Most of us make moral judgments every day; so most of us would like to think so. But how is such knowledge, or justification, possible? We do not seem to simply perceive moral truth, as we perceive the truth that there is a computer screen before us. We do not seem to simply understand it, as we understand that all roosters are male. And we do not seem to simply feel it, as we feel a bit hungry right now. Moral epistemology explores this problem about knowledge and justification.

First, this article explores the traditional approaches to the problem: foundationalist theories, coherentist theories, and contextualist theories. Then the article explores the non-traditional approaches: reliabilist theories, noncognitivist theories, ideal decision theories, and politicized theories. The article concludes with an introduction to naturalizing moral epistemology and to some relevant issues in metaethics.

Classifying Theories of Moral Epistemology
Traditional Approaches
Non-Traditional Approaches
Can Moral Epistemology Be Naturalized?
Moral Epistemology & Metaethics
References and Further Reading

1. Classifying Theories of Moral Epistemology

Below we introduce moral epistemology in terms of eight theories of moral epistemology. We divide these in half by distinguishing traditional from non-traditional approaches. By “traditional” we intend something more precise than just “old school.” So we launch our discussion of traditional approaches by defining our sense of “traditional.”

We conclude with two more detailed discussions. First, we introduce a moral epistemic debate of considerable recent importance, the debate about whether moral epistemology can be naturalized (roughly, moved in the direction of becoming scientific). Second, we discuss moral epistemology’s broader context as a subfield of metaethics (roughly, the part of ethical theory that examines the deepest assumptions behind our moral thought); we use this final discussion to introduce the problem of what the objects of moral knowledge could be.

2. Traditional Approaches

Foundationalist theories, coherentist theories, and contextualist theories represent the traditional approaches to moral epistemology. Reliabilist theories, noncognitivist theories, ideal decision theories, and politicized theories represent non-traditional approaches. By an approach to moral epistemology, we mean either (a) an attempt to explain how we can have moral knowledge, or at least justified moral beliefs, or (b) an attempt to argue that we cannot have one or both of these. The former are more or less non-skeptical, and the latter are more or less skeptical, approaches. This allows non-skeptical and skeptical approaches to compromise at the point of saying that we can have some justification for believing, but not knowledge of, some moral truths.

Approaches to moral epistemology are traditional only if they are committed to all of the following five (two moral and three epistemic) assumptions:

[Moral] Cognitivism: we have moral beliefs, and thus moral belief contents that are either true or false (but not both true and false).
[Moral] Realism: there are moral facts that can correspond to what moral claims represent as being the case, such as facts about the goodness or badness of people or the rightness or wrongness of their actions.
[Epistemic] The Necessity of Justified True Belief: If someone knows something, then at the very least one is justified in believing it; and it is true; and one believes it. If one is justified in believing it, then one has a decisively good reason to believe it, a reason that makes one epistemically responsible in believing it.
[Epistemic] Internalism: In order to be justified in believing something and therefore in order to know it, one must have in mind the factors that reasonably ground one’s right to believe it. The strongest internalist theories demand that these factors be immediately in mind, whereas the milder internalist theories demand only that they be available upon reflection. This seems to imply that one must possess (without any need for further experience or research) the grounds of good answers to all kinds of skeptics in order to be justified in believing something. However, it perhaps does not imply that one can recognize all of those reasons as such or that one can effectively articulate them.
[Epistemic] The Priority of Epistemic Structure: Theories of justification must also be theories of the structure of justification in response to the regress problem, which is discussed in the section on Traditional Skepticism.

a. Foundationalist Theories

According to foundationalism, all justified beliefs are either foundational or derived. Foundational beliefs or basic beliefs possess noninferential justification; derived beliefs do not. A foundational belief does not owe its justification to logical inference from other justified beliefs. A derived belief gets its justification through inference, either directly or indirectly, from foundational beliefs.

Where can we get noninferential justification for our foundational beliefs? This is one of the most difficult questions for any foundationalist theory. The two most common answers are experience (for instance, sense perception or introspection) and reason (for instance, grasp of the self-evident through understanding). Most foundationalist moral epistemic theories go for one or the other, or some blend, of these two very general answers. The two following sorts of theories are usually conceived in foundationalist terms.

Moral Sense Theories assert the existence of a uniquely moral sense by which we perceive rightness or wrongness. According to early Scottish versions of this theory, such as those of Frances Hutcheson ([1725]) and David Hume ([1740]), the perception in question is reflexive, grounded in a kind of sentiment or feeling, which is secondary to, and attendant upon, perceiving actions or states of affairs with our ordinary senses. Sometimes moral sense theories are described as intuitionist theories; more often “intuitionism” is used only for the following.

Moral Epistemic Intuitionist theories imply that we can non-perceptually recognize some moral truths in a way that can noninferentially justify us in believing them. According to W. D. Ross, who defended perhaps the most influential classical version of the theory, some moral propositions are self-evident, so that merely understanding them produces, at least in the best people, justification for believing them. His main examples are mid-level moral generalizations such as, ‘I have a prima facie duty (an unless-overridden-by-a-stronger-duty, duty) to keep my promises’. Ross’s intuitionism is rationalist: it grounds foundational justification for moral beliefs in a rational grasp of the self-evident ([1930]; 1936). Some intuitionist theories are less obviously rationalist. For instance, A. C. Ewing thought that we have a unique ability to detect “fittingness” in responses to circumstances, which is neither as straightforwardly rationalist as Rossian intuition nor as similar to sense perception as a moral sense theory would require (1949). Most historical moral and epistemic theories imply some form of intuitionism, and even the most radical departures from tradition. For instance, some naturalized moral epistemologies claim strong analogies with intuitionism. Some writers who have recently defended versions of moral epistemic intuitionism are Robert Audi (1997, 2004), Jonathan Dancy (1993), Brad Hooker (2000), and David McNaughton (2000).

b. Coherentist Theories

According to coherentism, all justified beliefs are inferentially justified; there are no foundational beliefs. Instead, what justifies us in holding beliefs are their relations of mutual support, that is, their coherence. Justification therefore accrues to beliefs only in virtue of their membership in coherent sets, and so cannot be assessed when beliefs are evaluated singly. Coherence itself is usually taken to be, at a minimum, logical consistency. Many coherentists argue that it requires not only logical consistency, but also explanatory potency or predictive value, similar to what good scientific theories exhibit.

The most important conception of coherence in recent moral epistemology is called reflective equilibrium. John Rawls is largely responsible for the contemporary importance of this conception. He proposed it in the context of arguing for his even more famous contractarian theory of justice; but as a moral epistemic idea, we can consider it apart from that context. According to Rawls, one achieves reflective equilibrium (narrowly conceived) when, and only when, one has brought all of her judgments about the rightness or wrongness of particular actions into ultimate harmony with all of one’s judgments about what it is generally or universally right or wrong to do. Reflective equilibrium is a moral epistemic ideal: Rawls does not suggest that anyone has achieved or will achieve it. Nevertheless, he thinks that one is more or less justified in holding the moral beliefs one does happen to hold according to, and in virtue of, the extent to which she approaches reflective equilibrium (1971: 48-51). Reflective equilibrium is a kind of epistemic balance across levels of generality, achieved by facing and resolving conflicts between particular and general moral beliefs by means that are supposed to sort themselves out in the long run.

Some coherentist moral epistemologists, such as Geoffrey Sayre-McCord, argue that a broader conception of reflective equilibrium, which includes balance among not only our moral beliefs but also our non-moral beliefs. For instance, Sayre-McCord thinks the broader conception is better because requiring consistency between our moral and our non-moral beliefs is likely to rule out perverse but coherent sets of moral beliefs (1996: 166-70).

c. Contextualist Theories

Among close family I take for granted certain moral beliefs that I would be hard-pressed to defend at a meeting of my philosophical colleagues. Concerning the maintenance of my car, I take for granted many things that I would not take for granted if it were a passenger jet. Epistemic contextualism seems to vindicate such practices. It is the view that justified beliefs can owe their justifications to beliefs that are (even if not justified) not in need of justification under the circumstances. Beliefs not in need of justification under the circumstances are contextually basic. Which beliefs are contextually basic in a given context depends on the sorts of considerations raised in our examples above: Who am I talking to?, How serious is it if I am wrong?, and so forth

Mark Timmons is a recent moral epistemic contextualist. He argues for a context-dependent conception of epistemic responsibility that he thinks supports (epistemic) contextualism especially well in the case of moral beliefs. In actual practice, what constitutes epistemic responsibility—for example, checking such and such counterpossibilities before believing—varies according to context. In the moral case, people are especially prone to take for granted, and thus take to be epistemically responsible, certain mid-level moral generalizations (of the sort W. D. Ross thought are intuitive) that pass current in their contexts. These thus tend to serve as contextually basic in moral belief (Timmons, 1996). Of course, how much real epistemic justification one can get by extrapolating from his epistemically responsible (even if not justified) beliefs can vary according to the truth of those beliefs. For instance, Nazis extrapolating from their peculiar, shared, anti-Semitic beliefs can get very little epistemic justification. After all, one can take the conception of epistemic justification that is accepted in one’s context to be epistemically significant when it is not, just as one can (in the arguably more idealized, less realistic, foundationalist and coherentist cases) take one’s beliefs to be foundational or coherent when they are not.

d. Traditional Skepticism

Each broad theory-type above is, among other things, an attempt to solve a particular skeptical problem: the regress problem of justification. The problem can be presented in the form of an argument for a general, and not specifically moral, epistemic skepticism:

If all justified beliefs owe their justifications via inference to other justified beliefs, then each justified belief owes its justification to other justified beliefs which owe their justifications to still further justified beliefs, and so on. Such chains of epistemic dependence must either
1. never end, and thus form infinite regresses of justified beliefs, or
2. end only when the chains form closed circles.
All justified beliefs owe their justifications (via inference) to other justified beliefs.
So all justified beliefs owe their justifications to chains of epistemic dependence of type (a) or type (b).
But, if (3), then human beings can have no justified beliefs because
1. human beings have finite minds and are thus incapable of possessing chains of epistemic dependence of type (a);
2. chains of epistemic dependence of type (b) add up to, at best, circular arguments; circular arguments are never good reasons to believe; so allegedly justified beliefs that fall into type (b) dependence are not really justified.
Hence, human beings can have no justified beliefs.

The apparent seriousness of this problem, combined with epistemic internalism’s demand that we face it head on, leads to the “priority of epistemic structure” assumption that is essential to traditional approaches. Foundationalism and contextualism try to defeat the regress argument by offering alternatives to premise (2). Coherentism tries to defeat it by offering holistic alternatives to the linear conception of epistemic dependence at work in premises (1) and (4).

To accept the soundness of the regress argument is to become a general, extreme kind of epistemic skeptic: it is to accept that we can have no justified beliefs and, thus, no knowledge. Such general, extreme epistemic skepticism is rare. Moral epistemic skepticism, on the other hand, is relatively common. It takes either weak or strong forms. According to weak (moral epistemic) skeptical theories, we can have justification for moral beliefs but we cannot have moral knowledge: the kinds or degrees of justification involved are too weak for knowledge. According to strong skeptical theories, we cannot even have justified moral beliefs.

At least one recent, strong moral epistemic skeptic is traditional (in our sense). Walter Sinnott-Armstrong thinks that the regress argument is sound, so long as by “beliefs” we mean “moral beliefs.” Perhaps, for instance, foundationalism is a good response to the regress problem in the case of our empirical—such as our perceptual—beliefs. In any case, he does not think that foundationalism works for moral beliefs. There are no good grounds, he argues, for accepting that we have a faculty that justifies foundational moral beliefs. Every attempt to argue that we do is essentially a form of dogmatism. It is an attempt to strongly insist on our most cherished moral beliefs in order to avoid having to defend them. Coherentism and contextualism fare even worse on Sinnott-Armstrong’s appraisal. They are not even viable as general epistemologies. No matter how coherent a set of beliefs is, there are any number of equally coherent sets that are inconsistent with it. So coherentism fails to explain how beliefs, in general, can be justified. Contextualists confuse mere persuasion with argument: for example, my ability to get you to agree to certain assumptions, and thus make them contextually basic, simply has no bearing on whether they are likely to be true, and, so, on whether we are justified in believing them (Sinnott-Armstrong,1996).

3. Non-Traditional Approaches

For various reasons, many philosophers reject one or more of the essential assumptions of traditional moral epistemology. Below we briefly introduce four sample kinds of non-traditional approaches. Unlike foundationalism, coherentism, and contextualism, these theories are all potentially compatible. There could be a reliabilist, noncognitivist, ideal-decision-based, politicized theory. Some of these are even, in the end, compatible with traditional theories (or close analogues of traditional theories). They all, however, reject one or more of the traditional assumptions as starting points.

a. Reliabilist Theories

I am probably average in my ability to correctly recognize dollar bills. Yet I am also, sadly, average in my lack of understanding of the complex physical, economic, sociological, and political conditions that make dollar bills be dollar bills. Somehow I nevertheless reliably recognize and daily form practically successful beliefs about dollar bills. If I am ever justified in believing that ‘here is a dollar bill’, I do not have in mind, and am not even capable of calling to mind without further research, all of the factors that make my belief true or that would justify it. Thus I cannot be justified, if traditional epistemic internalism is right, in believing that ‘here is a dollar bill’, despite my dollar-bill-reliability. David Copp (2000), the reliabilist moral epistemologist whose example this is, wants us to see that the traditional internalist outcome seems preposterous.

Of course I am justified in believing in many cases that ‘here is a dollar bill.’ So traditional epistemic internalism must be false. It is false because, Copp thinks, it is the reliability, or lack of reliability, of the processes by which we form beliefs that justifies, or fails to justify, our beliefs; not, as epistemic internalists insist, our deep skeptic-proof insight into their truth conditions. Whether we perceive, understand, or can even recognize, how such processes are reliable in us, as epistemic internalism demands, is beside the point.

Copp proposes and defends an anti-internalist, that is, externalist, moral epistemology. He argues that we (or at least the best of us) have a reliable moral sensitivity, much as we have a reliable dollar bill sensitivity. Our relevant moral sensitivity is made up of a certain combination of (i) a heightened tendency to notice morally relevant features of a situation, such as the pain produced by burning a cat alive and the much less morally significant enjoyment that doing this might bring to a gang of thugs; (ii) a reliable tendency to draw correct moral conclusions from these features, such as the conclusion that burning the cat, under the circumstances, is morally reprehensible; and (iii) a reliable tendency to be motivated in a morally appropriate way, such as being motivated to do something, if feasible, to prevent the thugs from burning the cat alive (2000; 55-58). We can, as ethical theorists do, legitimately struggle towards the exactly right combination of (i) – (iii). However we need not understand how they are connected with truth—a highly complicated matter of societal norms that appropriately arise from societies’ struggles to meet their “needs,” according to Copp—in order for our combinations of (i) – (iii) to justify our moral beliefs (1995). We need only have combinations that reliably produce true beliefs in us, in order for our (thus produced) moral beliefs to be justified.

b. Noncognitivist Theories

In his provocative attack on traditional, speculative philosophy, Language, Truth, and Logic, A. J. Ayer wrote ([1936]: 107):

…if I say to someone, “You acted wrongly in stealing that money,” I am not stating anything more than if I had simply said, “You stole that money.” In adding that this action is wrong I am not making any further statement about it. I am simply evincing my moral disapproval of it.

According to Ayer, moral language merely expresses emotion just as “a peculiar tone of horror” or “special exclamation marks” express feelings. It does not make claims: it has no content of a sort that can be true or false. Hence [moral] cognitivism—an essential ingredient of traditional moral epistemology—is false. So, the whole enterprise of moral epistemology, that is, the study of moral knowledge, is doomed from the start: there cannot be moral beliefs or truths, and because there cannot be justified true moral beliefs, there cannot be moral knowledge.

Ayer, however, does not mean to entirely relegate the concerns of moral epistemology to the dustbin. He only means to demote them. We can accept noncognitivism and still argue that some moral feelings are more reasonable or appropriate to given kinds of circumstances than others. We can have more or less justification (although not epistemic justification) for having, or tending to have, certain moral attitudes. We can thus have better and worse moral theories.

While we might think that noncognitivism degrades ethics too much by disconnecting it from the promise of truth, we might appreciate that it allows us to non-skeptically avoid a host of messy ethical and epistemic problems associated with moral realism. According to moral realism, moral claims represent the world as being thus and so; they are true when the world really is thus and so and false when it is not. It is hard to say for moral claims, however, what “thus and so” is supposed to be. Also, the very idea that moral “claims” represent the world as being a certain way is a suspect idea. It suggests that moral talk aims, like perceptual talk, at describing. But moral talk does not seem to aim at describing; it seems to aim at prescribing. Arguably, noncognitivism can make better sense of this than realism. Noncognitivism conceives moral talk as projecting moral emotion (Ayer, [1936]) or prescription (Hare, 1989) onto a perhaps otherwise indifferent world, rather than as representing the moral features of a world which contains no moral features.

Two especially influential recent noncognitivist theories are Simon Blackburn’s “quasi-realism” and Allan Gibbard’s “norm expressivism.” Blackburn’s quasi-realism combines an account of moral value as projected value with a sophisticated attempt to vindicate the rationality of certain indispensable (to moral discourse) practices that treat moral talk as if it were cognitive (1996; 1998). Gibbard’s norm-expressivism claims that moral judgment is a species of rationality judgment constituted by expressive, as opposed to cognitive, acceptance of norms or rules that determine in the moral case whether actions are forbidden, permitted, or required (1990).

c. Ideal Decision Theories

Ideal decision theories ascribe special philosophical importance to the moral decisions of idealized persons who decide under idealized circumstances. Only some ideal decision theories are moral epistemic theories (others are non-epistemic, for example, ethical or metaethical theories), and only some of those offer whole approaches to moral epistemology. Contractarianism and the sort of approach that Richard Brandt proposes are two ideal decision theories that are sometimes conceived as whole approaches to moral epistemology.

Contractarian theories seek to ratify moral claims by appeal to the agreement of fully rational, non-biased, well-informed people in real or, more often, imagined circumstances. For instance, John Rawls famously argued that principles of justice are morally binding on members of a society if and only if they would be unanimously agreed to by rational, relevantly-well-informed people in what he calls the “original position.” The original position is an imaginary situation walled off by a “veil of ignorance,” which prevents knowledge of the particular, personal features that engender biases, such as our sexes, ages, races, special tastes, talents, handicaps, or developed moral, political, or religious outlooks. Rawls, however, was a traditional coherentist when it came to moral epistemology. He did not view his contractarian decision procedure as either an ethical theory or a moral epistemology, but rather as a way of generating authoritative principles of justice that would dovetail with the best ethical theory and the best moral epistemology (1971).

Nevertheless, others have proposed and defended contractarian theories as ethical theories and/or moral epistemologies. For instance, a contractarian ethical theory might hold that actions are morally permissible if and only if they would not be rejected in something like Rawls’s original position. Some contractarian moral epistemologists think that discerning that a moral claim would be endorsed in something like the original position can justify someone in believing it (Gauthier, 1986; Morris, 1996). Although Rawls did not hold this view, he did see his method as a kind of access to deep facts about rationality itself, facts of the sort that his more traditional moral epistemology finds ultimately decisive.

Richard Brandt suggests a different, but related, ideal decision theory. A way to demonstrate the validity of a moral system is

…to show persons that if they were factually fully informed they would want a certain sort of moral system for the whole society in which they expect to live. (1996: 207-08)

This by no means makes moral knowledge easy to come by. But it does put it on the same sort of footing as our other knowledge, since all of our other knowledge is presumably about what the facts are, and to make a claim about what the facts are is to imply something about what it is like to be fully factually informed.

d. Politicized Theories

Most recent politicized theories are feminist theories. The very idea of feminist epistemology strikes many as a mistake. What could be more impartial, and less open to political interpretation, than standards of knowledge or justified belief? We may as well talk about feminist radio repair. However, feminist epistemologists often see the very mistake they want to address in such a response. This impartiality, or pretense of impartiality, in traditional epistemology blinds it to relevant information or standpoints of oppressed classes, such as women; or at least to the narrowness and biases that it is likely to have since its assumptions, methods, and so on were conceived and developed by socially privileged white men.

Anatole France ([1894]) famously wrote: “The law, in its majestic equality, forbids the rich, as well as the poor, to sleep under bridges, to beg in the streets, and to steal bread.” His irony is Marxist: Marx thought that the impartiality of laws can blind us to the very partialities they are designed to promote. Similarly, many feminist epistemologists argue that the alleged impartiality of traditional theories of justification or knowledge can blind us to the views of the world, and perhaps in particular the moral views of the world, they are designed to promote. Foundationalism, for instance, which looks on the surface like a logically motivated response to the regress problem of justification, has been considered to be just a method for vindicating the basic tenets of the foundationalist’s world view, whatever those happen to be.

What is it that white-male-dominated, traditional moral epistemology has missed? Let’s consider three kinds of feminist answers. (1) Susan Harding (1986) argues that the epistemic standpoints, that is, perspectives from which we collect evidence, of oppressed classes are epistemically better, that is, more likely to produce true beliefs, than the epistemic standpoints of oppressor classes, especially concerning the oppressor classes’ biases. For instance, an antebellum plantation owner would miss much that would be readily apparent to his lowliest slaves. For many topics, including moral ones, he is likely to live on some sort of epistemic Cloud Nine . (2) Traditional epistemology builds its misleading impartiality on taking knowledge to be an individual, rather than a community, activity. In fact, as the relative success of science illustrates, real knowing is a community activity: its body of knowledge improves only by surviving attempts by communities to refute it. By wrongly conceiving knowledge as an individual activity, traditional epistemology merely codifies the individual biases, including sexisms, of its conceivers. (3) Traditional epistemology is non-naturalized. So, it conceives actual knowledge-ascription or justification-ascription practices as mere subjects of epistemic evaluation, never as raw material upon which to base epistemic principles. Once we reverse this trend, and go in for naturalized epistemologies (see below), we can regard the actual social and linguistic circumstances of knowledge ascriptions as starting points. Once we do that, we can have, at best, only half of a good moral epistemic theory if we ignore the special moral epistemic practices, concerns, and paradigms provided by women (as traditional moral epistemology arguably has). Feminist moral epistemologists, such as Margaret Urban Walker (1996) and Lorraine Code (2000), have been leaders in the effort to naturalize moral epistemology.

4. Can Moral Epistemology Be Naturalized?

To naturalize a philosophical subject is to somehow bring it under the purview of natural science. What this means is controversial; but it is usually thought to involve both substantial and methodological projects. Substantially, it involves attempting to confine theories to existence claims that science countenances, or could eventually countenance. Methodologically, it involves attempting to limit philosophical inquiry to methods whose validity science can, or could eventually, vindicate.

There is nothing new about attempts to affect substantial naturalization in ethics. Over two centuries ago, Jeremy Bentham ([1781]) tried to conceive moral claims as substantially about quantities of pleasure and pain, and thus as about something that might be scientifically modeled and studied. Efforts to naturalize episstemology are a more recent phenomenon, with a more methodological focus. The naturalized epistemology movement was launched by W. V. Quine (1969), who rejected the traditional epistemological project of trying to discover, through conceptual analysis, skeptic-proof, a priori conditions for knowledge or justification. He proposed, instead, that epistemology be reconceived as a branch of empirical psychology. Many of his followers propose less radical reforms. What they have in common is that they reject a fully traditional approach in favor of “…an anti-skeptical, or at least non-skeptical, empirically informed investigation of the grounds of knowledge” (Copp, 2000: 39).

The effort to naturalize moral epistemology is even more recent. Most attempts take one or more of three forms: reliabilism, feminism, and scientism (or so we will call it). Below, we say a bit about each of these and introduce two objections that naturalized moral epistemologists strive to overcome.

Some epistemic reliabilists try to naturalize epistemology, in general, by identifying epistemic justification with observable and measurable consequences: such as facts about the reliability of the various processes by which we arrive at beliefs (for example, Goldman, 1994). Their rejection of traditional epistemic internalism makes room for an anti-skeptical stance by allowing justification and even knowledge in the absence of answers to traditional skeptical problems like the regress problem. David Copp (2000), whose moral epistemic reliabilism we sketched above, conceives his reliabilism as a naturalized moral epistemology, and defends it against several objections, including those we mention below.

Feminists stand to gain from naturalized moral epistemology room to urge the relevance of their various empirical critiques of the impartiality of traditional ethics and epistemology. The traditional pretense of impartiality in epistemology was largely upheld by the traditional conception of epistemology as only susceptible to a priori investigation. Naturalized moral epistemology opens the door to, and can even privilege, the sorts of psychological and sociological facts that feminist moral epistemologists seek to call attention to.

Theories that promote scientism propose and evaluate moral epistemic theories on the basis of current scientific theory, such as current sociology, psychology, artificial intelligence, and neuroscience. For instance, Paul Churchland (2000) tries to reconceive moral epistemology so that moral knowledge has much less to do with the truth of general moral and epistemic principles than with a kind of skill by which we build and more or less ably negotiate complex brain-to-social-space relations.

One of the largest sources of objections to naturalized ethics or epistemology concerns the essential normativity (value-ladenness, prescriptivity) of both ethics and epistemology. Ethics is essentially normative because it is about what we should do, not what we do. Epistemology is essentially normative because it is about what our epistemic standards should be, not what they are. Science, on the other hand, is purely descriptive. Its subject matter—how the natural world in fact is—is not normative. How then can ethics or epistemology be brought within the purview of natural science? If we try to assimilate the naturalization of both ethics and epistemology into a naturalized moral epistemology, then the problem gets even worse: neither ethics nor epistemology can derive their essential normativity from the other.

Arguably, moral and epistemic principles must be general, in the sense that they cover indefinitely many particular instances of rightness, goodness, knowledge, and so on. Science can produce generalities, such as natural laws, on the basis of generalizing from particular observations. However, as Immanuel Kant ([1785]: 63) pointed out, in order to soundly generalize to moral [or epistemic] principles in the scientific way, one would have to already know which examples, which observations or theoretical entities, are morally relevant; and one can only know that on the basis of other general moral [or epistemic] principles. Thus, if we are limited to scientific generalization from examples, then we are trapped, unable to generate the general moral [or epistemic] principles we need in order to get started.

5. Moral Epistemology & Metaethics

Metaethics is the part of ethical theory which studies the deep, often non-moral assumptions behind our moral thought. Here are some important metaethical topics:

moral epistemology;
moral semantics, the study of how and what moral language means;
moral ontology, the study of what sort(s) of reality underwrites the truth or reasonableness of moral claims or attitudes; and
moral psychology, the study of the nature of, and relations among, moral mental states, such as morally-relevant beliefs, desires, intentions and motivations.

Such topics are difficult to pursue in a vacuum. Not only does each involve an intersection or overlap between ethical theory and some other enormous topic, their problems are often inextricably interdependent.

For instance, the problem of what the objects of moral knowledge could be is larger than moral epistemology; it is also a problem of moral ontology and moral semantics. We conclude with a brief look at this problem. We access it through the general outline of a dilemma posed by A. J. Ayer against moral cognitivism. We borrow from Michael Smith (1994) the idea of using Ayer’s dilemma as a window into recent metaethics. However, we do not closely follow Ayer in developing the details of the dilemma nor explore Smith’s more sophisticated treatment.

Ayer’s Dilemma (Ayer, [1936]: 103-06): Assume moral cognitivism. If any moral claims are true, some sort of reality—something we can think of them as representing—underwrites their truth. This reality must be either something natural or something non-natural. However, if it is something natural, then it must fall victim to G. E. Moore’s arguments against ethical naturalism. If it is something non-natural, then it must either also fall victim to Moore’s arguments against ethical naturalism or fall victim to a host of other insuperable problems. So no moral claims are true.

Obviously, Ayer’s Dilemma leans heavily on G. E. Moore’s arguments against ethical naturalism. We briefly describe two of these, consider how they also preclude some non-naturalist theories, and then give some examples of the alleged host of other insuperable problems that confront the ethical non-naturalist.

Like Moore, let’s simplify by calling “the Good” whatever it is that all true moral claims collectively represent as being the case. Ethical naturalism is the view that the Good is something natural. By “natural” Moore meant “…the subject matter of the natural sciences and…psychology,” or “…all that has existed or will exist in time” ([1903]: 92). Moore’s two most famous arguments against ethical naturalism are the naturalistic fallacy argument and the open question argument. According to the naturalistic fallacy argument, any attempt to identify the Good with something natural must commit a fallacy because goodness is a normative (value-laden, prescriptive) property and because nature is decidedly non-normative (value-neutral, descriptive). According to the open question argument, good definitions “close” certain questions for competent users of the term defined. For instance, competent users of the term, “triangle,” cannot wonder whether there are any round triangles. But no identification of the Good with something natural can have this feature: competent users of “good” will always be able to wonder whether the natural states of affairs in the definition are really good, and vice versa ([1903]).

Many philosophers think that Moore’s definition of “natural” is flawed. However, this matters little for our purpose since his arguments seem to work, if they work, against ethical naturalist theories of every stripe, and against many non-natural ones. They work, if they work, against any position that identifies the Good with something non-normative, even if it is something theological.

What remains, then, is to identify the Good with something non-natural and normative. This seems to imply that the Good must be sui generis, that is, utterly unique. This is the option which, according to Ayer’s Dilemma, must fall victim to “a host of other insuperable problems.” We will briefly mention three of these. First, if the Good is sui generis, then we cannot defend the possibility of moral knowledge, since we have no independent evidence of an epistemic faculty that apprehends something as being both morally significant and utterly unique. Second, if the Good is sui generis, then knowing what is good could not provide motivation for doing what is good. Third, if the Good is sui generis, then we are left without any possible explanation for why moral properties supervene on natural (or at least non-normative) properties; that is, why we cannot conceive any difference in correct moral assessment when we cannot point to any difference in the plain facts.

Responses to Ayer’s Dilemma: One way to respond to Ayer’s Dilemma is to accept it. This leaves two alternatives: keep cognitivism and become a skeptic or, as Ayer preferred, abandon cognitivism. J. L. Mackie (1977) kept cognitivism and became a skeptic. He argued that our realm of moral discourse, just like our realm of, say, Santa Claus discourse, is nothing more nor less than a large body of false claims. Ayer ([1936]), R. M. Hare (1989), Simon Blackburn (1996, 1998), and Allan Gibbard (1990) all chose, instead, to abandon cognitivism and to defend on a noncognitivist basis the possibility of something like moral knowledge,.

Another option is to keep cognitivism and reject either the anti-naturalistic or the anti-non-naturalistic horn of the dilemma. Let’s consider post-Ayer ethical naturalist theories, first.

Some ethical naturalists think that the Good is both natural and sui generis. For instance, “Cornell Realists,” such as Nicolaus Sturgeon (1989), David Brink (1989), and Geoffrey Sayre-McCord (1988) think that every particular instantiation of the Good can be identified with a natural state of affairs, such as an instance of moral rightness with some act of kindness under a natural description. However, they think that the Good, itself, cannot be identified with anything these natural instantiations all have in common. Instead, moral properties like goodness and rightness have irreducible, and thus sui generis, explanatory power of their own.

Others think that the Good is natural and not sui generis: it reduces to some natural property or properties. For instance, Peter Railton argues that it reduces to being what we would want for us, as we really are now, to want, if we had “unqualified cognitive and imaginative powers, and full factual and nomological information about…[our]…physical and psychological constitution.” (1986: 173-74). Other “Reductionist” naturalists include Gilbert Harmon (1975); Richard Brandt (1979); David Lewis (1986); and Frank Jackson, Philip Pettit and Michael Smith (2004). Reductionist naturalists typically respond to Moore’s anti-naturalistic arguments by arguing that their reductions—that is, their identifications of the Good with something natural—are a posteriori (experience-based) identifications, rather than a priori, and thus are immune to his criticisms.

Among ethical non-naturalists we must include Moore ([1903]). He accepted that the Good is sui generis, and he argued that we have an intuitive epistemic faculty that apprehends goodness and thus grounds our beliefs about what is good or right. Although his positive view is often rejected as a reduction to absurdity of ethical non-naturalism, it has had important recent defenders, for example, Panayot Butchvarov (1989).

Most recent defenders of ethical non-naturalism reject the sui generis view, or at least Moore’s version of it. Some argue that we can tell what constitutes the telos (roughly, proper function) of something that has one, provided that we know enough about it; and thus we can know what constitutes the Good for it. The facts about telos for some things—especially the most morally considerable things, like people—cannot all be identified with something natural, at least not in anything like Moore’s sense of “natural.” (Foot, 1978; MacIntyre, 1984)

Many non-naturalists reject that the Good exists, per se, in the world that science studies, and they argue instead that it arises as a necessary byproduct of any attempt to pursue purposive, or goal-driven, rational activities—such as perceiving or understanding or inferring or deliberating or intending or acting. The Good belongs, as John McDowell (1994) says, to the “space of reasons.” Such views are capable of broadly Aristotelian, Kantian, or existentialist development. In any case, they can require that the “space of reasons” be sensitive to facts (whether natural, and thus unique to the world that science models and studies, or non-natural) and logic. The Aristotelian turn conceives the space of reasons as a product of social relations, engendered by the necessary formation of interpersonal relationships and conveyed by societally-sanctioned forms of education (McDowell, 1994; MacIntyre, 1984). The Kantian turn conceives the “space of reasons” in more individualistic terms: the choices of individuals are morally evaluable according to whether the principles implicit (or explicit) in them pass some objective test, or tests, of rationality, such as being permitted by Kant’s Categorical Imperative (Korsgaard, 1996; Audi, 2004). Finally, the existentialist turn views facts and logic as radically underdetermining the rationality of choices, a short-coming that can only be made up for by adopting some thoroughly subjective criteria, usually some kind of authenticity, or trueness to oneself (Kierkegaard, [1843]; Sartre, 1992).

6. References and Further Reading

Audi, Robert, Moral Knowledge and Ethical Character, Oxford: Oxford University press, 1997.
Audi, The Good in the Right: A Theory of Intuition and Intrinsic Value, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
Ayer, A.J., Language, Truth and Logic [1936], New York: Dover Publications, Inc., 1952.
Bentham, Jeremy, The Principles of Morals and Legislation, [1781] Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 1988.
Blackburn, Simon, “Securing the Nots: Moral Epistemology for the Quasi-Realist,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Blackburn, Simon, Ruling Passions, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1998.
BonJour, Laurence, The Structure of Empirical Justification, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1985.
Brandt, Richard, “Science as a Basis for Moral Theory,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Brink, David, Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
Campbell, Richard & Hunter, Bruce, “Introduction,” eds. Richmond Campbell and Bruce Hunter, Moral Epistemology Naturalized, Calgary, Alberta: University of Calgary Press, 2000.
Chisholm, Roderick, The Foundations of Knowing, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1982.
Code, Lorraine, “Statements of Fact: Whose? Where? When?,” eds. Richmond Campbell and Bruce Hunter, Moral Epistemology Naturalized, Calgary, Alberta: University of Calgary Press, 2000.
Copp, David, Morality, Normativity, and Society, New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Copp, David, “Four Epistemological Challenges to Ethical Naturalism,” eds. Richmond Campbell and Bruce Hunter, Moral Epistemology Naturalized, Calgary, Alberta: University of Calgary Press, 2000.
Dancy, Jonathan, Moral Reasons, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 1993.
Dancy, Jonathan, “The Particularist’s Progress,” eds. Brad Hooker and Margaret Little, Moral Particularism, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2000.
Ewing, A. C., The Definition of Good, New York: The Macmillan Company, 1949.
Foot, Philippa, Virtues and Vices, University of California Press, 1978.
Gauthier, David, Morals by Agreement, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1986.
Gewirth, Alan, Reason and Morality, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1978.
Gibbard, Allan, Wise Choices, Apt Feelings, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1990.
Goldman, Alvin, “What is Justified Belief?” ed. by Hilary Kornblith, Epistemology Naturalized, 2nd Ed., Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1994.
Harding, Sandra, The Science Question in Feminism, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1986.
Hare, R(ichard) M., Essays in Ethical Theory, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989.
Hare, R(ichard) M., “Foundationalism and Coherentism in Ethics,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Harman, Gilbert, Morality, New York: Oxford University Press, 1977.
Hooker, Brad, Ideal Code, Real World, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2000.
Hume, David, A Treatise of Human Nature, [1740] 2nd Ed., ed. by L. A. Selby-Bigge, rev. by P. H. Nidditch, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
Hutcheson, Frances, An Inquiry Into the Original of Our Ideas of Beauty and Nature, [1725] New York: Garland Publishers, 1971.
Jackson, Frank, Pettit, Philip, and Smith, Michael; Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
Kant, Immanuel, Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals [1785], tr. by Mary Gregor, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
Kierkegaard, Soren, Fear and Trembling / Repetition, tr. Howard V. Hong, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1983, pp. 54-67.
Korsgaard, Christine, The Sources of Normativity, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Mackie, J. L., Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong, New York: Penguin, 1977.
MacIntyre, Alasdair, After Virtue, 2nd Ed., Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press, 1984.
McDowell, John, Mind and World, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1994.
McNaughton, David, “Intuitionism,” Blackwell Guide to Ethical Theory, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 2000, pp. 268-287.
Miller, Alexander, An Introduction to Metaethics, Cambridge: Polity Press, 2003.
Moore, G. E., Principia Ethica, [1903], rev. edn., Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
Morris, Christopher, “A Contractarian Account of Moral Justification,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Quine, W.V.O., “Epistemology Naturalized,” Ontological Relativity and Other Essays, New York: Columbia University Press, 1969.
Railton, Peter, “Moral Realism,” Philosophical Review 95, 1986.
Rawls, John, A Theory of Justice, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1971.
Ross, W. D., The Right And The Good [1930], Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 1988.
Ross, W. D., The Foundations of Ethics, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1936.
Sartre, Jean-Paul, Notebook For an Ethics, [posthumous publication] tr. David Pellauer, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1992.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey, “Moral Theory and Explanatory Impotence,” Midwest Studies 12, 1988, pp. 433-57.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey, “Coherentist Epistemology and Moral Theory,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Scanlon, T. M., What We Owe to Each Other, Cambridge, MA: Belknap Press, 1998.
Sidgwick, Henry, The Methods of Ethics [1907], Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 1981.
Sinnott-Armstrong, Walter, “Moral Skepticism and Justification,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Smith, Michael, The Moral Problem, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers Ltd, 1994.
Sturgeon, Nicholas, “Moral Explanations,” Essays on Moral Realism, ed. by Geoffrey Sayre-McCord, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1989, 229-55.
Timmons, Mark, “Outline of a Contextualist Moral Epistemology,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Walker, Margaret Urban, “Feminist Skepticism, Authority, and Transparency,” eds., Walter Sinnott-Armstrong and Mark Timmons, Moral Knowledge?: New Readings in Moral Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.

Author Information

Peter Tramel
Email: peter.tramel@usma.edu
United States Military Academy
U. S. A.

Hellenistic Astrology

Hellenistic and Late Antiquity astrologers built their craft upon Babylonian (and to a lesser extent Egyptian) astrological traditions, and developed their theoretical and technical doctrines using a combination of Stoic, Middle Platonic and Neopythagorean thought. Astrology offered fulfillment of a desire to systematically know where an individual stands in relation to the cosmos in a time of rapid political and social changes. Various philosophers of the time took up polemics against astrology while accepting some astral theories. The Stoic philosopher Posidonius was alleged to embrace astrology and write works on it (Augustine, De civitate dei, 5.2). Other Stoics such as Panaetius and (late) Diogenes of Babylon were primarily adverse to astrological determinism. For some philosophers such as Plotinus, horoscopic astrology was absurd for reasons such that the planets could never bear ill will toward human beings whose souls were exalted above the cosmos. For others, such as the early Church Fathers, ethical implications of astrological fatalism were the main point of contention, as it was contrary to the emerging Christian doctrine of free will. The Gnostics, who for the most part believed the cosmos is the product of an evil and enslaving creator, thought of the planets as participants in this material entrapment. Prominent Neoplatonists such as Porphyry, Iamblichus, and Proclus found some aspects of astrology compatible with their versions of Neoplatonic philosophy. The cultural importance of astrology is attested to by the strong reactions to and involvement with astrology by various philosophers in late antiquity. The adaptability of astrology to various philosophical schools as well as the borrowing on the part of astrologers from diverse philosophies provides dynamic examples of the rich “eclecticism” or “syncretism” that characterized the Hellenistic world.

Introduction
1. Babylonian Astrology in the Hellenized World
2. Hellenistic Theorization and Systemization of Astrology
Early Greek Thinking
Philosophical Foundation of Hellenistic Astrology
The Astrologers
The Skeptics
1. The New Academy (Carneades)
2. Sextus Empiricus
Hermetic and Gnostic Astrological Theories
Neoplatonism and Astrology
Astrology and Christianity
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

a. Babylonian Astrology in the Hellenized World

Astrology, loosely defined as a method of correspondences between celestial events and activity in the human realm, has played a role in nearly every civilization. Its role in the late-Hellenistic era is of special concern, particularly due to its complex interaction with Greek philosophy, as well as its claims on the life of an individual. A horoscopic chart (also “birth chart,” “natal chart,” or “horoscope”) is a list of planetary positions against a backdrop of zodiac signs, divided into regions of the sky (with reference to the rising and setting stars on the horizon) on the basis of one’s exact time and place of birth. Such charts form the basis of “natal astrology” or “genethlialogy,” which started in Babylon but was later developed in Hellenized Greek speaking regions.

The earliest surviving horoscopic chart pertaining to an individual is dated 410 B.C.E. in Babylon. Babylonian astrology flourished from the seventh century to the Seleucid era (late fourth century). However, astral religion and divination based on star omens have a much longer history in Mesopotamia. Stars were considered to be representations of gods whose favors could be courted through prayers, magical incantations and amulets. The triad of Anu, Enlil, and Ea corresponded not with individual stars or planets but to three bands of constellations. Traces of the basic characters of the planetary gods, such as the malevolent nature of Mars/Nergal (the god of destruction and plagues) and Venus/Ištar (the goddess of love), can be found in Hellenistic astrology. Given the small available sample of Late Babylonian horoscopic tablets containing planetary placements and laconic predictions (around 28 extant), it is very difficult to come to solid conclusions about the theoretical ground for the practice of the earliest horoscopic astrologers. The case will be different in the Hellenistic culture in which theoretical grounding was important for the development of the practice, and in which there is more extensive textual evidence.

Given the dynamic tension resulting from Greek philosophy meeting Egyptian, Babylonian, Persian and Jewish religions and ideologies, and the “syncretism” of cross-cultural influences, the Hellenistic era provided fruitful soil for the cultivation of what began primarily as a Mesopotamian system of celestial omens. Before Alexander’s conquest, the practice of astronomy and astrology in Babylon flourished but was not yet of much interest to the Greek thinkers. Babylonian priests/astrologers, notably Berossus, who settled on the island of Cos, are thought to be responsible for introducing astrology to Greece and the surrounding area. Plato mentions those who seek celestial portents in the Timaeus (40c-d), while the student of Plato who authored the Epinomis paved the way for application of astronomical studies to astral piety.

As the intellectual center in Egypt, Alexandria is a likely location for major developments in Hellenistic astrology. A portion of what Garth Fowden (in Egyptian Hermes) classified as “technical Hermetica,” material typically earlier than the “philosophical Hermetica,” represents a part of the early Hellenistic astrological corpus. Surviving Greek astrological writings, catalogued over a period of fifty years in a work called the Catalogus Codicum Astrologorum Graecorum (CCAG), reveal that for the sake of credibility, many of the Hellenistic astrologers attributed the earliest astrological works to historical or mythologized figures such as the pharaoh Nechepso, an Egyptian priest associated with Petosiris. Hermes is a legendary figure credited with the invention of astrology. Some fragments attributed to Hermes survive while some of the Nechepso/Petosiris work from the mid-second century B.C.E. survives in quotes by later authors. Asclepius, Anubio, Zoroaster, Abraham, Pythagoras, and Orpheus are additional figures having astrological works penned in their names. There are late Hellenistic references to three Babylonian astronomers/astrologers, Kidinnu (Kidenas), Soudines (the source of some material for second century C.E. astrologer, Vettius Valens), and Naburianos. The rivalry between the Seleucid and Ptolemaic kingdoms may be reflected in the astrologers’ varying attributions of the origins of astrology to Egyptians or Babylonians (called the Chaldaeans). Various astrological techniques and tables are either attributed to Egyptians or Chaldaeans, but by late antiquity, the source for specific techniques and approaches were often wrongly attributed. By the second century B.C.E., Babylonian astrology techniques were combined with Egyptian calendars and religious practices, Hermeticism, the Pythagorean sacred mathematics, and the philosophies of the Stoics and middle Platonists.

b. Hellenistic Theorization and Systemization of Astrology

Hellenistic astrology displays the influence of a variety of philosophical sources. However, given the divergent and ever multiplying streams of thought in the Hellenized world, practical astrology did not necessarily conform to one particular philosophical model offered by the major philosophical schools. However, as outlined below, the Neopythagoreans, Platonists and Stoics provided the foundational influence on the development of the art.

After a system or systems of Hellenistic astrology quickly developed, the later practitioners and writers did not follow any one philosophical influence as a whole. In fact, the surviving instructional texts only scantily betray the philosophical positions of the authors. Vettius Valens, whose Anthologiarum is one of the most valuable sources for historians of this subject, indicates Stoic leanings. The astrologer, astronomer, and geographer whose work greatly influenced later development of astrology, Claudius Ptolemy (fl. 130-150 C.E.), using Aristotelian influenced manners of argumentation that had been absorbed by other Hellenistic schools such as the Middle Platonists and the Academic Skeptics, sought to portray astrology as a natural science, while dismissing a good portion of doctrine due to lack of systematic rigor. The later Platonic Academy had its fair share of astrological interest – head of the academy in the first century C.E., Thrasyllus, for example, acted as an astrologer to Emperor Tiberius and is credited for works on astrology and numerology. Neoplatonists Porphyry, Iamblichus and Proclus all practiced or accepted some form of astrology conforming to their unique contributions to Neoplatonism. It is difficult to imagine that the practice of astrology would have been divorced from philosophy by philosophers who were also astrologers. The idea of astrology, as a systematic account of fate, had a pervasive impact on the influential thinkers of the time who helped to shape the theoretical and cosmological understanding of the practice. Thinkers in the skeptical Academy and Pyrrhonic schools sought to attack the theoretical underpinnings of the practice of astrology, using a variety of arguments centering around freedom, the ontological status of the stars and planets, and the logical or practical limitations of astrological claims.

We now turn to the philosophies and philosophical schools of the Hellenic and Hellenized world that made the spread and acceptance of Babylonian astrology possible.

2. Early Greek Thinking

a. Fate, Fortune, Chance, Necessity

The role of Fate was often interchangeable with that of the gods in early Greek thinking. Fate implied foreknowledge, which was divine and sometimes dispensed by the gods. The intervention of the gods in human affairs also presented the possibility of two paths of fate, based on a moral choice. A decision that pleased or displeased the gods (such as the choice Odysseus must make regarding the Oxen of the Sun (Odyssey, Book XII) could set one off on a road of inexorable circumstances to follow.

For the pre-Socratic philosophers, personified powers – such as Moira (Fate or Destiny) Anankê(Necessity), Nemesis, Heimarmenê (Fate), Sumphora (Chance) and Tukhê (Fortune or Chance) – took on both metaphysical significances and personifications that blurred any distinction between the theological and the ontological. In thinkers such as Anaximander, Moira and Tukhê play a part in cosmology that exceeds and is possibly even prior to the gods. While the Olympian gods may be given foresight into the workings of Moira, they were often left without the power to transgress this transcendental dispensation of justice. Nature and the gods were both encompassed by Moira. At this time in Greek thinking, Fate and Fortune, and Zeus as its capricious dispenser, fell outside the pale of human understanding, for leading a virtuous life was no insurance of protection from material ruin. This sense of futility resulted in the pessimism of Ionian thinkers such as Mimnermus and Semonides. The attitude toward Moira and Tukhê by Archilochus is wholly pessimistic, for Moira and Tukhê were the sole dispensers of good and evil, with no possibility of mediation. We see the emergence of the question of the role of human responsibility in justice and injustice in early Greek thinking (that is, Solon), but it is unusual to see sharp distinctions between circumstantial Fate that dispenses good or evil and the human response to fate through virtue that was to later develop in Hellenistic thinking (such as found in the later Stoic position that happiness is self-control in spite of an immutable Fate). Theognis, however, offers a proto-Stoic forebearance of Fate and triumph of human character, while he expresses the frustration of apparent injustice in the dispensation of good to the wicked and bad to the innocent. Democritus reacted to skepticism based on the whims of Chance by favoring a causal determinism ruled by necessity (anankê). Attribution of events to Chance, he claimed, was an excuse for one’s lack of vigilance of the chain of causality (Fr. 119, Diels-Kranz). While not claiming such a thing as absolute chance, Democritus retained chance to indicate an obscure cause or causes.

We find in pre-Socratic thinking a stage set for the overcoming of the limitations of knowledge about the laws of the cosmos, not simply on a universal scale, but on the level of individual fortune as well. Hellenistic astrologers, in part, attempted to provide a complex astral logic to explain the apparent injustices of Fate. They attempted to fill this gap of knowledge and turn Chance and Fate into a predictable science for the initiated.

b. Greek Medicine

The development of Greek medical theory brought about a distinction between a basic “human nature” (koinê phusis) and an “individual nature” (idiê phusis). Greek medicine was motivated by the idea that nature has a unity and lawfulness. In the manner of Democritian Atomism, even Tukhê is causal, but not necessarily predictable. A Hippocratean would classify an individual’s psychophysical nature into one of four types based on the qualities of hot, cold, moist, and dry. Astrologers borrowed and elaborated upon the psychology and character typology found in early medical theory (cf. Manilius, Astronomica, 2.453-465; Ptolemy, Tetrabiblos, 3.12.148). In turn, astrology in the Hellenistic era was to in turn inform medical theory with 1) zodiacal and planetary melothesia (the association of astral phenomenon at birth with physical type), 2) iatromathematics (which included consideration of auspicious and inauspicious times), 3) sympathies and antipathies between healing plants and celestial bodies, and 4) prognostication of the course of an illness, of life expectancy or recovery, based on the moment a person fell ill. Melothesia and iatromathematics are found in the works of astrologers Manilius, Teucer (Teukros) of Babylon, Ptolemy, and Firmicus Maternus, as well as a variety of anonymous and pseudepigraphal works. (cf. Serapion, CCAG, 1.101-102; Pythagoras, CCAG, 11.2.124-138).

Galen’s own position on astrology was nuanced, for he rejected some aspects of astrological doctrine as it had been applied to medicine (particularly the Pythagorean numerology used in critical days, and the association of thirty-six healing plants with the Egyptian decans), while he supported other astrological considerations such as the Moon phases and relationship to planets for prognosis. Two of his works pertaining directly to this topic, On the Critical Days and Prognostication of Disease by Astrology. InOn the Critical Days Galen claimed an empirical basis for his selective acceptance, favoring astronomical accuracy (with fractional measures) over the Pythagorean doctrines in astrology (such as seven days per quarter cycle of the Moon). A passage in On the Natural Faculties (1.12.29) also alludes to his support of astrology in general and to a lost work on the physician Asclepiades where he dealt with the topics of omen, dreams and astrology. The context of the passage reveals that his theoretical acceptance of astrology is due to his Vitalist view of Nature (that the natural world is a living organism) as opposed to the Atomistic view of Nature (that all things are composed of inanimate atoms). Nature, for Galen (drawing upon the Vitalist position of Hippocrates) possesses faculties of attraction and assimilation of that which is appropriate (e.g., for an organism) and of expulsion of that which is foreign. Nature also provides the soul with innate ideas such as the virtues of courage, wisdom, temperance, etc. Omens and astrology are signs of Nature’s providence and artistry of the principles of assimilation and expulsion. The Atomist (Epicurean) school rejected astrology and divination by dreams and omens because they believed there is no causality and purpose in Nature, so there is no means of producing these “signs” or correspondences and no means of prediction by way of them.

c. Plato and Divination

Babylonian astrology was not wholly unknown to the Greeks prior to Alexander’s campaign. Plato, for instance, demonstrates an awareness of divination by the stars in the Timaeus dialogue, in which the protagonist criticizes divination by the stars without the means of astronomical calculation (logizethai) and a model (mimêmaton) of the heavens:

To describe the dancing movements of these gods, their juxtapositions and the back-circlings and advances of their circular courses on themselves; to tell which of the gods come into line with one another at their conjunctions and how many of them are in opposition, and in what order and at which times they pass in front of or behind one another, so that some are occluded from our view to reappear once again, thereby bring terrors and portents of things to come to those who cannot reason – to tell all this without the use of visible models would be labor spend in vain. 40c-d, Donald J. Zeyl translation, emphasis mine).

Each astronomical consideration listed in this passage, the conjunctions and oppositions, the occlusion or heliacal settings of planets and stars, the retrogradation are basic considerations in Babylonian (and subsequently Greek) astronomy. This passage may allude to early exposure of the Greeks to astrological methods more akin to numerology rather than based on astronomical observation, for the use of visible models can more accurately measure celestial phenomena. It may also be taken as evidence that Plato is at least aware of the Babylonian practice of omenic astrology or the horoscopy that emerged in the fifth century B.C.E. Also in the Timaeus, Plato mentions the “young gods” whose job it is to steer souls. The identity of these gods would become a problem in later Platonism, but they are established, at least by the first century as planetary god (Philo, De opificio mundi, 46-47). As this dialogue was treated with great importance in Platonism during the formative period of Hellenistic astrology, this passage could have been used by those looking for philosophical justification for the practice. Plato further expresses in the Laws(7.821a-822c; 10.986e) the value of studying astronomy for the sake of astral piety. He points out that the name planetos (from “to wander”) is a misnomer, for the Sun, Moon and planets display a cyclical regularity in their course that can be more accurately understood by astronomical research. We can suspect, in this regard, the influence of contemporary astronomers and students in the academy such as Eudoxus. Astral piety, however, is to be contrasted with “astrology” proper that originated with the attempt to apply reason, order, and predictability to phenomena that had been previously considered to be merely astral omens.

Plato held in low regard the divinatory arts that are not prophetic, i.e., a madness (manic/mantic) directly inspired by the gods (cf. Ion). He expressed an attitude of ambiguity toward divination revealed in the double-edged characterization of Theuth (cf. Phaedo, 274a), the inventor of number, calculation, geometry, astronomy, games and writing. Just as writing results in a soul’s forgetfulness through the mediation of symbols, semiotic or sign-based prediction, as astrology was often considered, is inferior to directly inspired prophecy (Phaedo, 244c).

d. Ages, Cycles, and Rational Heavens

As early as Hesiod, the Greeks mythologized ages of civilization. The Golden Age, in which the gods walked upon the earth, gave way to Silver, then Bronze, then Iron Age. Empedocles taught of a natural cycle of the interplay of Love and Strife: Love and harmony dominated one Age, then Strife in the next Age. Plato also expresses world ages, particularly in the Statesman or Politicus (269d-274d). Throughout the myths in this dialogue and others, he introduced the notion of a “cosmos” or a rational order and ontological hierarchy of the spheres of heavenly beings, elements, daimons, and earthly inhabitants. The cosmologies in Plato’s dialogues marked the emergence of a rational cosmic order in place of earlier cosmogonies. His Timaeus dialogue, with its detailed story of the creation of the world, was to become, perhaps the most influential book along with the Septuagint in the late Hellenistic era). Babylonian astronomical cycles would, soon after Plato, fuse with Greek cosmologies. In the Myth of Er in the Republic, Plato describes the cosmos as held together by the Spindle of Necessity, such that the spheres of the fixed stars and the planets are held together by an axis of a spindle. Sirens sing to move the spheres (or whorls) while the Three Moirai participate in turning the wheel. Each whorl has its own speed, with the sphere of the fixed stars moving the fastest and in the direction opposite those of the planets. In the Phaedrus (245c-248c) dialogue, he further illustrates the Law of Destiny that governs souls who accompany the procession of the gods in a heavenly circuit for a period of 1000 years. If the souls remember the Good (those of the philosophers) they will regain lost wings of immortality in three circuits or 3000 years. Otherwise they fall to the earth and continue a cycle of rebirths for 10,000 years. Immortal souls dwell in the rim of the heavens among the stars.

This leads to another significant development introduced by Plato, one that would become critical for the Hellenistic spread of astrology and astral piety – the ensouled nature of celestial bodies. Plato gives the planets and stars a divine ontological status absent in the writings of the pre-Socratics, many of whom took the planets and stars to be material bodies of one substance or another. (for example, Anaxagoras [Plato,Apology, 26d]; Xenophanes [Aetius, De placitis reliquiae, 347.1]; Anaximander [Aristotle De caelo, 295b10]; Leucippus and Democritus [Diogenes Laertius, Lives, 9.30-32]). In the Laws (10.893b-899d; 12.966e-967d), Plato posits that Soul is older than created things and an immanent governor of the world of changing matter. Secondly, the motion of the stars and other heavenly bodies are under the systematic governance of Nous. That the circuits of the planets and stars have an ordered regularity or rationality, and that they are always in motion, indicates that they are immortal and ensouled (cf. Phaedrus, 245c). While leaving open the question of whether the Sun, Moon and planets create their own physical bodies or inhabit them as vehicles, Plato includes in the Athenian’s argument that celestial beings are in fact gods, and (unlike the thought of the Atomists) are engaged in the affairs of human beings (Laws, 10.899a-d). Pre-Socratic philosophers such as Anaxagoras who believed that mind (Nous) governs the cosmos, failed in their cosmological account by not also recognizing the priority of soul over body (Laws, 12.967b-d). The conception of mind moving soulless bodies, noted the Athenian, led to common accusations that studying astronomy promotes impiety.

As Babylonian astronomical cycles met with a rational and ensouled Greek cosmos, the basis for both Stoic eternal recurrence and technical Hellenistic astrology was formed.

3. Philosophical Foundation of Hellenistic Astrology

a. Astral Piety in Plato’s Academy

The Platonic dialogue Epinomis, most likely written by Phillip of Opus, demonstrates a transformation of the view of the heaven that soon paved the “western way” for astrology. This dialogue shows the transformation of the planets into visible representations of the Olympian gods, just as the Babylonian planets were images of their pantheon. The older names of the planets encountered in Homer and Hesiod (and in Plato’s Republic) designated their appearance rather than divine personification. Jupiter was shining (Phaithon), Mercury was twinkling (Stilbôn), Mars was fiery (Pureos) and Venus was the bright morning star and evening star (Phosphoros and Vesperos). In the Epinomis, the planets are given proper names for Greek gods, though the author leaves open the question of whether the celestial beings are the gods themselves or likenesses fashioned by the gods (theous autous tauta humnêteon orthotata, ê gar theous eikonas hôs agalmata hupolabein gegonenai, theôn autôn ergasamenon, 983e). The new names of planets as Greek gods corresponded loosely with the astral deities of Babylonian astrology, such as the identification of ruling Olympian, Zeus, with the planet Jupiter, replacing the principle Babylonian god Marduk. Ištar (female as evening star, male as morning star) became Aphroditê/Venus, Nergal (god of destruction) Ares/Mars, Nabu Hermes/Mercury, Ninib Kronos/Saturn, and Sin became the female lunar deity Selênê.

The author of Epinomis extends the sentiment of astral piety evident in the Laws, and goes so far as to say that the highest virtue is piety, and that astronomy is the art/science that leads to this virtue (989b-990a) – for it teaches the orderliness of the celestial gods, harmony, and number. While Plato himself would never place the heavenly gods in direct control of a person’s destiny, the distinction between the fatalism of such a control measured by astrology and an astral piety that permitted some intervention of gods in human affairs was not sharply drawn. Does the care of the gods for “all things great and small” (epimeloumenoi pantôn, smikrôn kai meizonôn, 980d) mean that it is through their activities or motions they control, guide or occasionally intervene in human matters? While we do not yet see a clear distinction between astral piety and practical astrology, later texts on mystery cults, Gnosticism, Hermeticism, and magic demonstrate that someone who either worships stars, or is concerned with their ontological status, need not be technically proficient in astronomy. Nor must they believe that life is fated by astrally determined necessity. Likewise, the technical Hellenistic astrologers who calculated birth charts and made predictions did not necessarily practice rituals in reverence to planetary gods. While there is no clear evidence for a unified school in which technical astrologers were indoctrinated into both technique and theory of the craft, the fact that the Hellenistic techniques (barring the basic foundation of Babylonian astrology) had developed in a variety of conflicting ways speaks to the possibility of several schools of thought in theory, practice, and perhaps geographic distance. As each astrologer contributed their own techniques or variations on techniques, the technical material quickly multiplied, and students of astrology had many authoritative writers to follow. The most likely scenario is that the practicing astrologers possessed a variety of viewpoints about the life and “influence” of the planets and stars, based on available cosmological views in religion and philosophy. While borrowing freely from Stoic, Pythagorean and Platonic thought, the astrologers who would soon emerge varied theoretically on issues such as which aspects of earthly existence may or may not be subject to Fate and the influence of the stars, and whether or not the soul is affected by celestial motions and relationships.

b. Stoic Cosmic Determinism

Although the founder of Stoicism, Zeno of Citium, integrated fate into the system of physics, the first Stoic to write a treatise On Fate (Peri heimarmenês) is Chrysippus of Soli (280-207 B.C.E.). Xenocrates and Epicurus both penned lost works of the same title prior to his (Diog. Laert., 4.12; 10.28). Given the influence of Xenocrates on the Stoa on matters as important as oikeôisis, there is no reason to think that all of the issues of fate and freedom discussed by Chrysippus originate with him. Later Stoics such as Boethus, Posidonius and Philopator, dedicated works to fate, a topic that would become a critical issue for all Hellenistic schools of thought. The development of Hellenistic astrology is placed in the context of these theories.

i. Fate and Necessity

Stoic theory of fate involves the law of cause and effect, but unlike Epicurean atomism, it is not a purely mechanistic determinism because at the helm is divine reason. Logos, for the Stoics, was the causal principle of fate or destiny. This principle is not simply external to human beings, for it is disseminated through the cosmos as logos spermatikos (seminal reason) which is particularly concentrated in humans who are subordinate partners of the gods. Individual logoi are related to the cosmic logos through living in harmony with nature and the universe. This provided the basis of Stoic ethics, for which there is the goal of eupoia biou or smooth living rather than fighting with the natural and fated order of things. Chrysippus makes a distinction between fate (heimarmenê) and necessity (anankê) in which the former is a totality of antecedent causes to an event, while the latter is the internal nature of a thing, or internal causes. By its nature, a pot made of clay can be shattered, but the actual events of the shattering of a specific pot are due to the sum total of external causes and inner constraints. Fate, in general, encompasses the internal causes, though to be fated does not exclude the autonomy of individuals because particular actions are based on internal considerations such as will and character. Some events are considered to be co-fated by both external circumstances and conscious acts of choice. Diogenianus gives examples of co-fatedness, e.g., the preservation of a coat is co-fated with the owner’s care for it, and the act of having children is co-fated with a willingness to have intercourse (Stoicorum veterum fragmenta, 2.998). Character or disposition also plays a part in determining virtue and vice. Polemical writers such as Alexander of Aphrodisias characterize the Stoic position as maintaining that virtue and vice are innate. However, it is more accurate to say that for the Stoics an individual is born morally neutral, though with a natural inclination towards virtue (virtue associated with reason/logos) that can be enhanced through training or corrupted through neglect. Though morally neutral at birth, a human being is not a tabula rasa, but has potentialities which make him more or less receptive to good and bad influences from the environment. An individual cannot act contrary to his or her character, which is a combination of innate and external factors, but there is the possibility of acquiring a different character, as a sudden conversion. Since character determines action the ethical responsibility rests with the most immediate causes. An often cited example is that of a cylinder placed on a hill – the initial and external cause of being pushed down the hill represents the rational order of fate, while its naturally rollable shape represents will and character of the mind (Aulus Gellius, Noctes Atticae, 7.2.11). Cultivation of character through knowledge and training was thought to result in “harmonious acceptance of events” (which are governed by the rational plan of the cosmos), whereas lack of culture results in the errors of pitting oneself against fate (Gellius, 7.2.6).

ii. Stoic-Babylonian Eternal Recurrence

Berossus, a Babylonian priest who settled on the island of Cos and the author of Babuloniakos, is often credited for bringing Babylonian astrology to the Greek-speaking world. Because he is thought to have flourished around 280 B.C.E., he is not the first to expose Greek speakers to this art, but he is known for founding an astronomical and astrological school. Kidinnu and Soudines, two Babylonian astronomers mentioned by second century C.E. Vettius Valens, also contributed to Hellenistic astronomy and astrology. Although many of the technical and theoretical details of pre-Hellenistic Babylonian astrology in Greece are lost in all but a few tablets, the doctrine of apokatastasis or eternal recurrence is attributed to Berossus by Seneca (Quaest. nat., 3.2.1). One scholar of the history of astronomy (P. Schnabel,Berossus und die babylonisch-hellenistische Literatur, Leipzig 1923) argued that Kidinnu possessed a theory of “precession of the equinox” prior to Hipparchus. Precession occurs due to a slight rotation of the earth’s axis resulting in a cyclical slippage of the vernal point in reference to the stars. (See section on Ptolemy for more on precession) From this was concluded an eternal recurrence based on the precession of the vernal point through the constellations. Schnabel’s theory, however, had been refuted by Neugebauer. Whatever the case may be, it is likely that Babylonian cosmological theories influenced the founding Stoics, particularly Chrysippus.

The early Stoic version of the eternal recurrence is that a great conflagration (ekpurôsis) marks a stage in the cycle of the reconstitution of the cosmos (apokatastasis). One cycle, a Great Year (SVF, 2.599), would last until the planets align in their original position or zodiac sign in the cosmos (SVF, 2.625). Each age would end in Fire, the purest of elements and the irreducible cosmic substance, and would be followed by a restoration of all things. This fire, for the Stoics, was a “craftsmanly fire” (pur tekhnikonidentified with Zeus and of a different nature than the material fire that was one of the four elements. In the reconstitution of the world, the fiery element would interact with air to create moisture, which then condenses into earth. The four elements would then organize in their proper measures to create living beings (SVF, 1.102). By Necessity, the principle cohesive power of the cosmos, the same souls which existed in one cycle would then be reconstituted in the cosmos and would play the same part in the same way, with perhaps an insignificant variation or two. This concept from the early Stoa is sometimes known as the “eternal recurrence.” Because human souls are rational seeds of God (Logos, Zeus, Creative Fire), the conflagration is an event in which all souls return to the pure substance of creative fire (pur technikon), Zeus. This is not to be understood as an “afterlife” of human souls, as one would find in Christianity, for example. God, then restored in his own completion, assesses the lives of the previous cycle and fashions the next great age of the world that will contain an identical sequence of events. Heraclitus, whom the Stoics claimed as a precursor, possessed an earlier doctrine of conflagration, though it is not to be assumed that his generation and decay of the cosmos was measured by the planetary circuits, for its movement, to him, is a pathway up and down rather than circular (Diog. Laert., 9. 6). As reported by Philo, the only Stoics to have rejected the eternal recurrence include Boethus of Sidon, Panaetius, and a mature Diogenes of Babylon (De aeternitate mundi, 76-7).

Astrological configurations were specified as part of the Stoic-Babylonian theory of eternal recurrence. According to Nemesius,

The Stoics say that when the planets return to the same celestial sign [sêmeion], in length and breadth [mêkos kai platos], where each was originally when the world was first formed, at the set periods of time they cause conflagration and destruction of existing things. Once again the world returns anew to the same condition as before; and when the stars are moving again in the same way, each thing that occurred in the previous period will come to pass indiscernibly. (SVF, 2.625, tr. Long and Sedley, Hellenistic Philosophers V. 1, p. 309).

The word sêmeion used by Nemesius could represent any celestial indicator, though the typical word for “sign of the zodiac” was zôidion. The celestial position of “length and breath” (latitude and longitude) is more specifically identified by second century C.E. astrologer Antiochus as the last degree of the zodiac sign of Cancer or the first degree of Leo. A variation of this theory of apokatastasis includes anantapokatastatis, which is an additional destruction by water which occurs when the planets align in the opposing sign, Capricorn. Such destruction by a Great Flood during this alignment was also attributed to Berossus by Seneca. Fourth century astrologer turned Christian, Firmicus Maternus, associatedapokatastasis with the Thema Mundi (or Genesis Cosmos), which is a “birth chart” for the world consisting of each planet in the 15th degree of its own sign. For the sake of consistency with the Stoic eternal cosmos, Firmicus claimed this chart does not indicate that the world had any original birth in the sense of creation, particularly one that could be conceived of by human reason or empirical observation. The Great Year contains all possible configurations and events. Because it exceeds the span of human records of observation, there is no way of determining the birth of the world. He claimed that the schema had been invented by the Hermetic astrologers to serve as an instructional tool often employed as allegory (Mathesis, 3.1). A more common Genesis Cosmos mentioned in astrological texts is a configuration of all planets in their own signs and degrees of exaltation hupsoma), special regions that had been established in Babylonian astrology.

iii. Divination and Cosmic Sympathy

The eternal recurrence doctrine in Stoicism entails justification of divination and belief in the predictability of events. The Sun, Moon and planets, as gods, possess the pur technikon and are not destroyed in theekpurôsis (SVF, 1.120). While their physical substance is destroyed, they maintain an existence as thoughts in the mind of Zeus. Because the gods are indestructible, they maintain memory of events that take place within a Great Year and know everything that will happen in the following cycles (SVF, 2.625). Divination, for Stoicism, is therefore possible, and even a divine gift. Stoics who accepted divination include Chrysippus, Diogenes of Babylon, and Antipater (SVF, 2.1192). The presupposition that divination is a legitimate science was also used by Chrysippus as an argument in favor of fate. Cicero, however, argued for the incompatibility of divination and Stoicism (De fato, 11-14), particularly the incompatibility between Chryssipus’ modal logical (which allows for non-necessary future truths) and the necessary future claimed by divination’s power of prediction. These non-necessary future truths include all things that happen “according to us” (eph’ hêmin). The example argument presented by Cicero, “If someone is born at the rising of the Dogstar, he will not die at sea,” would not, by his account, fall under the category of non-necessary truths since the antecedent truth is necessary (as a past true condition). Therefore the conclusion would also be necessary according to Chrysippus’ logic. Cicero mentions Chrysippus’ defense against charges of such contradictions, but regardless of the success or failure of Chysippus’ defense against them, the issue for the possibility of divination, for the Stoics, was not considered a logical contradiction between fate and free will. The eph hêmin in Stoicism was based on a disposition of character that, while not a causal necessity, would lead one to make decisions between the good, bad, and indifferent in accordance with nature. Because human beings are by nature the rational seeds (logoi spermatikoi) of the Godhead, their choices will correspond to the cosmic fate inherent in the eternal recurrence, and would not alter that which is divined. For Chrysippus, at least, the laws of divination are accepted as empirically factual (or proto-science) and not as a matter of logicalconnectivity between past, present, and future. Since divination occurs as a matter of revelation thoughsigns, the idea that there can be knowledge of a necessary causal antecedent leading to a future effect is not the principle behind it (cf. Bobzein, p. 161-170). The Stoic argument for divination through signs would be as follows: if there are gods, they must both be aware of future events and must love human beings while holding only good intentions toward them. Because of their care for human beings, signs are then given by the gods for potential knowledge of future events. These events are known by the gods, though not alterable by them. If signs are given, then the proper means to interpret them must also be given. If they are not interpreted correctly, the fault does not lie with the gods or with divination itself, but with an error of judgment on the part of the interpreter (Cicero, De divinatione, 1.82-3; 1.117-18).

Another theory in support of divination and by extension astral divination, is that of cosmic sympathy. Cosmic sympathy was already prevalent in Hipparchean medical theory, though Posidonius is credited for its development in the Stoic school. Posidonius, though, claimed to have drawn this notion from Democritus, Xenophanes, Pythagoras and Socrates. Stoic physical theory holds that all things in the universe are connected and held together in their interactions through tension. The active and passive principles move pneuma, the substance that penetrates and unifies all things. In fact, this tension holds bodies together, and every coherent thing would collapse without it. Pneuma as the commanding substance of the soul penetrates the cosmos. This cosmos, for the Stoics, is both a rational and sensate living being (Diog. Laert., 7.143). The Stoics thought that the cosmos is ensouled and has impulses or desires (hormai). Whereas in Platonism these impulses are conflicting and need the rational part of the soul to govern them, in Stoicism desires of the cosmic soul are harmoniously drawn toward a rational (though not entirely accessible to human beings) end, which is Logos, or Zeus’ return to himself through the cosmic cycle of apokatastasis. So the idea of cosmic sympathy supports divination, because knowledge of one part of the cosmos (such as a sign) is, by way of the cohesive substance of pneuma, access to the whole. In contrast to Plato’s disparaging view of divination that it is not divinely inspired but based on the artless fumbling of human error, the Stoic view, for the most part, is that rational means of divination can be developed. The push to develop a scientific (meaning systematic and empirical) knowledge-based divination finds its natural progression in mathematically based astrology.

Stoic-influenced astrologers went a step further than Stoic philosophers to define innate potentials of character by assigning them to the zodiac and planets. Virtuous and corrupt characteristics are identified as determined by the potential of the natal chart, while external circumstances are indicated by the combination of this chart with transits of planets through time and certain periods of life set in motion by the configurations in the natal chart. For instance, in his list of personality characteristics for individuals born with certain zodiac signs on the horizon, Teukros of Babylon (near Cairo) includes character traits that are not morally neutral. For example, those born when the first decan of Libra is ascending are “virtuous” (enaretous), while those born when the third decan of Scorpio is ascending “do many wrongs” or are “law-breakers” (pollous adikountas).

iv. The Attitude of Stoic Philosophers Towards Astrology

While it is clear that Stoic philosophy influenced the development of astrology, the attitude of the Stoa towards astrology, however, varied on the basis of the individual philosophers. Cicero stated that Diogenes of Babylon believed astrologers are capable of predicting disposition and praxis (one’s life activity), but not much else. Diogenes, though, is said to have calculated a “Great Year” in his earlier years (Aetius, De placitis reliquiae, 364.7-10). His turn to skepticism changed his view on Stoic ekpurosisand likely modified his view on astrology. Middle Stoic Panaetius is said to have rejected astrology altogether. That an astrological example is used by Cicero to illustrate a contradiction in Chrysippus’ logic and divination does not necessarily mean that Chrysippus himself had much exposure to or took an interest in astrology. (Cicero’s example is, “If someone is born at the rising of the Dogstar, he will not die at sea.” Si quis (verbi causa) oriente Canicula natus est, is in mari non morietur. De fato, 12). In Chrysippus’ time, Hellenistic astrology had not yet been formulated systematically. However, given that the example is based on a consideration of importance to Babylonian astrology, the rising of the fixed star Sirius, the possibility exists that Chrysippus or one of his contemporaries discussed astrology in the context of logic and divination.

Posidonius was alleged by Augustine to have been “much given to astrology” (multum astrologiae deditus) and “an assertor fatal influence of the stars” (De civitate dei 5.2). His actual relationship to astrology, however, is more complicated, but there are several reasons to think that he supported astrology. For one, in his belief that the world is a living animal, he followed Chrysippus in identifying the commanding faculty of the world soul as the heavens (Diog. Laert., 7.138-9. Cleanthes considered it to be the Sun). Secondly, Posidonius had a strong research interest in astronomy and meteorology. He was the first to systematically research the connection between ocean tides and the phases of the Moon. His research in this area possibly led him to his doctrine of cosmic sympathy, as he considered natural affinities among things of the earth. Cosmic sympathy allows for an association between signs (within nature that can extend to planets and stars) and future events without direct causality. If the higher faculty of the cosmos is located in the heavens, then it is more likely that these signs would carry weight for Posidonius. Thirdly, Cicero, who can be given more credibility than Augustine by having attended Posidonius’ lectures, mentions him in connection with astrology in De divinatione (1.130). Fourthly, Posidonius (as a Platonic-influenced thinker) believed idea that the signs of the zodiac (zôdia) are ensouled bodies – living beings (Fr. 149, Edelstein-Kidd / Fr. 400a, Theiler). However, given that Posidonius is flourishing at the same time as the earliest textual evidence for Hellenistic astrology (first century B.C.E.; some “technical” Hermetic fragments about Solar and Lunar observations may be earlier), it is difficult to say what type of astrology he would have had an interest in – whether it had been remnants of the Babylonian omen-based astrology, or the beginning formulation of a systematic Greco-Roman astrology. Because he was widely traveled, he may have gained exposure to one or more astrologers or schools of astrologers. With his observations of the connection between seasonal fluctuations of the tides and the Solar/Lunar cycles, he apparently refuted Seleucus, a Babylonian astronomer who believed that the tides also fluctuation according to the zodiac sign in which the Moon would fall; he claimed the tides were regular when the Moon would be in the equinoctial signs of Aries or Libra and irregular in the solstitial signs of Capricorn, Cancer (Fr. 218, Edelstein-Kidd / Fr. 26, Theiler). This observation would not have necessarily been considered an astrological one, though it is schematized according to characteristics of the zodiac rather than lunations and seasons, and such schematizations were quite common in Hellenistic astrology. It cannot be said with certainty whether Posidonius’ advocacy of cosmic sympathy lent support to the development of astrology or if this development itself reinforced Posidonius’ own theories of cosmic sympathy and fate.

The importance of astrology in politics of first century Rome was aided by its alignment with Stoic fatalism and cosmic sympathy. Balbillus, son of Thrasyllus and astrologer to Nero, Seneca, and a certain Alexandrian Stoic, Chaeremon, were all appointed tutors to L. Domitius. Chaeremon (who Cramer, p. 116, identifies with the Egyptian priest/astrology in Porphyry’s Letter to Anebo and in Eusebius’Praeparatio evang., 4.1) wrote a work on comets (peri komêtôn suggramma) that cast these typically foreboding signs in a favorable light. Seneca, too, wrote a work on comets (Book 7 of Quaestiones naturales), in which he portrays some as good omens for the Empire (cf. Cramer, p. 116-118).

c. Middle Platonic and Neopythagorean Developments

So far in this account of the theoretical development of Hellenistic astrology, the pre-Socratic thinkers contributed a deep concern for fate and justice. Plato contributed an orderly and rational cosmos, while those in the early Academy displayed an astral piety that recognized the planets as gods or representations of gods. The Stoics contributed theories of fate and divination, that already had an astrological component with the Babylonian contribution to the Eternal Recurrence. Cosmic sympathy, present in Greek medicine and popularized by the middle Stoic Posidonius, provided astrologers with a theoretical grounding for the associations among planets, zodiac signs, and all other things. One notable Stoic contribution to Hellenistic astrology which distinguishes it from the Babylonian is the incorporation of Chryssipus’ principle of two forces, active and passive, manifest in the activities of the four elements. Fire and air were active, earth and water passive. The astrologers later assigned these elements and dynamic qualities to each sign of the zodiac. Further philosophical developments by the Middle Platonists and the Neopythagoreans would then lead to astrology as a system of knowledge due to its systematic and mathematical nature. The systematic nature would make it plausible to some and a worthy or dangerous foe to others. These developments set astrology apart, epistemologically speaking, from other manners of divination such as haruspicy (study of the liver of animals), or dream interpretation.

The union between Pythagorean theory and Platonism should come as no surprise given Plato’s late interest in Pythagoreanism. From the early academy onward, elements of Pythagorean theory became part and parcel of Platonism. Speusippus wrote a work on Pythagorean numbers (Fr. 4), and he would become influential in this regard, if not as directly on subsequent Academy members as on Neopythagorean circles. He and Xenocrates both offered cosmic hierarchies formed from the One and the Dyad. The One, or Monad, is a principle of order and unity, while the Dyad is the principle of change, motion, and division. The manner in which these principles are related was a critical issue inherited from the early Academy. Xenocrates (Fr. 15) believed that stars are fiery Olympian Gods and in the existence of sublunary daimons and elemental spirits. We see in Xenocrates both the identification of Gods with stars (as we saw in Phillip of Opus) and the notion that Gods are forces of Nature, thereby creating an important theoretical issue for astrology, namely what is the domain of influence of the planetary gods, as the Olympians are identified with the planets. He also believed that the world soul is formed from Monad and Dyad, and that it served as a boundary between the supralunary and sublunary places. Xenocrates’ cosmology would be highly influential on Plutarch, who elaborated on the roles of the world soul, the daimons, the planets and fixed stars.

The middle Platonists, many of whom believed themselves to be true expounders of Plato, were influenced by other schools of thought. The physical theories of Antiochus of Ascalon are very Stoic in nature. For example, he incorporated the Stoic “qualities” (poiotêtes), which were moving vibrations that act upon infinitely divisible matter, into his cosmology. The unity of things is held together by the world soul (much as it is held together in Stoic theory by pneuma). Antiochus equated the Stoic Logos/Zeus with the Platonic World Soul, and this soul of the cosmos governs both the heavenly bodies and things on earth that affect humankind. He also accepted the Stoic Pur Tekhnikon (Creative Fire) as the substance composing the stars, gods, and everything else. There is little to indicate that Antiochus held in his cosmology the notion common to some other Platonists of transcendent immateriality; his universe, like the Stoics, is material. On the subject of fate and free will, he argues against Chrysippus (if he is in fact the philosopher identified as doing so in Cicero’s De fato and Topica) by accepting the reality of free will rather than the illusion of free will created simply by the limitations of human knowledge in grasping fated future events. Antiochus’ view on other beings in the cosmos, particularly the ontological status of stars and planets, may be found in his Roman student Varro who stated that the heavens, populated by souls (the immortal occupying aether and air), are divided by elements in this order from top to bottom: aether, air, water, earth.

From the highest circle of heaven to the circle of the Moon are aetherial souls, the stars and planets, and these are not only known by our intelligence to exist, but are also visible to our eyes as heavenly gods.” (from Natural Theology, tr. Dillon, Middle Platonists, p. 90).

Daimons and heroes, then, were thought to occupy the aerial sphere. The importance of Antiochus for the development of Hellenistic astrology may be his break with the skepticism of the New Academy, one which allowed the Middle Platonists to espouse more theological and speculative views about the soul and the cosmos while anticipating Neoplatonic theories. In Alexandria, which, not by coincidence would become a hotbed for astrological theory and practice, Platonism incorporated strong Neopythagorean elements. Eudorus of Alexandria, who wrote a commentary on Plato’s Timaeus, contributed to the importance of Timaean cosmology in middle and Neoplatonic thought. References to Eudorus’ are found in Achilles’ work, Introduction to Aratus’ Phenemona. Achille used Eudorus as a source for this work that also contains references to Pythagorean theories of planetary harmonies. We know from Achilles that Eudorus followed the Platonic and Stoic belief that the stars are ensouled living beings (Isagoga, 13). This intellectual climate is likely the immediate context for the development of systematic astrology – with its complex classifications of the signs, planets, and their placements in a horoscope, and the numerological calculations used for predicting all sorts of events in one’s life.

i. Ocellus Lucanus

The revival of Pythagoreanism by the mid-first century B.C.E. brought about the acceptance of pythagorica of “Timaeus of Locri” and Ocellus Lucanus as genuinely “early” Pre-Platonic Pythagorean texts, though both mostly like date around the second century B.C.E., or at latest, the first half of the first century B.C.E. The Neopythagorean texts just mentioned are significant for the development of Hellenistic astrology. They represent cosmological theories that likely were used as justification for astrology.

In On the Nature of the Universe (peri tês tou pantos phuseôs), Ocellus argues for a perfectly ordered harmonious universe that is immutable and unbegotten. By appealing to the empirical rationale that we cannot perceive the universe coming to be and passing away, but only its self-identity, he concludes the eternity of the whole, including its part. This whole though is divided into two worlds, the supralunary and the sublunary. The heavens down to the Moon comprise a world of unchanging harmony that governs the sublunary realm of all changing and corruptible activity. In Platonic manner, the unchanging (the Monad) governs and generates the changing (the Dyad). In Pythagorean manner, the divine beings in the unchanging realm are in perfect harmony with one another through their regular motions. Visible signs for the unchanging harmony and self-subsistence of the universe are found in the harmonious movements of things in relation to one another. Based on the nature of the relations listed – “order, symmetry, figurations (skhêmatismoi), positions (theseis), intervals (diastaseis), powers, swiftness and slowness with respect to others, their numbers and temporal periods” (1.6) – he clearly means the movements of planets and stars. This list comprises the primary factors by which astrologers would assess the strength and qualities of planets in a given horoscope as the basis for the formulation of predictive techniques and statements. For instance, swiftness of planets was thought to make them stronger while slowness (which occurs close to the retrogradation motion) weakens the planet, while “figurations” (skhêmatismoi) is a word used for aspects, or the geometrical figures planets make to one another and the ascending sign (horoskopos). Temporal periods were assigned by astrologers in a variety of ways, though usually based on the “lesser years” of the planets, the time it took for one planet to complete its revolution with respect to a starting point in the zodiac. “Intervals” (diastaseis) were measures that were calculated either between planets or between planets and the horizon or culminating points in a horoscope; in the case of the latter, the intervals were used in astrology to determine strong and weak areas in the horoscope. The former notion of intervals was used for determining various time periods of one’s life assigned to each planet (cf. Valens, Anthologiarum, 3.3). “Numbers” was a term used to indicate a planet’s motion (as appearing from earth) as direct or retrograde. “Powers” (dunameis) of the planets are combinations of heating, cooling, drying, moistening – these powers made planets benevolent or malevolent (cf. Ptolemy, Tetrabiblos, 1.4). Ocellus goes on to name these powers as hot, cold, wet, and dry, and he contrasts them with the “substances” (ousiai) or elements of fire, earth, water and air. The powers and substances, or “qualities” and “elements” as they are more commonly called, were used in horoscopic astrology to describe the natures of the planets and zodiac signs. In Ocellus’ explanation of astral causality, the powers are immortal forms that affect changes on the sublunary substances (2.4-5).

Whether or not Ocellus and other Neopythagoreans are at the forefront of formulating these particular astrological rules, he provides a metaphysical basis for the notion that the planets and stars effect changes on earth. He is further described as saying that the Moon is the locus where immortality (above) and mortality (below) meet. He also says the obliquity of the zodiac, the pathway of the Sun, is the inclining place at which the supralunary generates activity in the sublunary realm. The Sun’s seasonal motion conforms to the powers (hot, cold, wet, and dry) that bring about changes in the substances (elements); the ecliptic path inclines these powers into the realm of strife and nature.

In his discussion on the generation of men, Ocellus argues, in more of an Aristotelian than Platonic sense (as found in On Generation and Corruption, that the only participation of men in immortality is through the gift by divinities of the power of reproduction. Following rules of morality in connubial relations results in living in harmony with the universe. Immoral transgressions, though, are punished by the production of ignoble offspring. A manner of cosmic sympathy (as found in Greek medicine) plays a role in determining that the circumstances of conception (such as a tranquil state of mind) will reflect upon the nature of the offspring. This notion is in keeping with the fact that astrologers studied charts not only for the moment of birth, but for conception as well. The only major difference is that for the astrologers, the circumstances of the birth appear to be reflected universally at a given time and not the direct result of moral or immoral actions as it is for Ocellus. The moment of birth or conception for the astrologers is reflected in all things of nature and in any activities initiated at that particular moment, as reflected in the positions of the planets and signs. The technical astrologers typically did not include reflections on moral retributions in their manuals of astral fate. They were primarily concerned with detailing knowledge of fate for its own sake, though speculation about such matters as retribution and rebirth is not excluded by astrological theory.

ii. Timaeus Locrus

The Hellenistic text attributed to Timaeus Locrus, On the Nature of the World and the Soul, purports to be the original upon which Plato drew for his dialogue of his name. For the most part, it consists of a summary of the material by Plato. The circles of the Same and the Different carry the fixed stars and the planets respectively. The sphere of the fixed stars containing the cosmos is granted the Pythagorean perfect figure of the dodecahedron. One addition of note for the theory of astrology is the doctrine of the creation of souls. The four elements are made by the demiurge in equal measure and power, and Soul of man is made in the same proportion and power. Individual souls of human beings are fashioned by Nature (who has been handed the task by the demiurge of creating mortal beings) from the Sun, Moon, and planets, from the circle of Difference with a measure of the circle of the Same that she (Nature being hypostasized as the female principle) mixes in the rational part of the soul. There appears in this to be a difference in individual souls reflecting different fates based on the composition. While this merely reiterates what is found in Plato’s Timaeus (42d-e), the supposition that one could read this account straight from Timaeus Locrus gave authority to these notions. It is likely that these ideas filtered to the astrologers, who would devise methods for seeking out the ruling planet (oikodespotês) for an individual (see section on Porphyry). Perhaps what they were seeking in the horoscope was one of the “young gods” whose task it was to fashion the mortal body of each soul and to steer their course away from evils. As mentioned above, some philosophers associated the young gods with the planets.

Astrological fragments of a writer “Timaeus Praxidas” date to the same period (early to middle first century B.C.E.), but there is little textual evidence to indicate that these are one and the same writer. What it at least indicates is that the legend of Timaeus lent authority to the astrological writers.

iii. Thrasyllus

Thrasyllus (d. 36 C.E.), a native of Alexandria, was not only the court astrologer to Tiberius, but a grammarian and self-professed Pythagorean who studied in Rhodes. Given that he published an edition of Plato’s works (and is known for the arrangement of the dialogues into tetralogies), and that he wrote a work on Platonic and Pythagorean philosophy, we can assume that his astrological theory represents Middle Platonism of the early first century C.E. However, a summary of his astrological work “Pinax” (tables), indicates that he is drawing upon earlier sources, particularly the pseudepigrapha of “Nechepso and Petosiris” and Hermes Trismegistus. A numerological table, perhaps containing zodiac associations to numbers as that found in Teukros of Babylon, is also attributed to Thrasyllus. It appears that his own philosophy contains a mixture of Hermetic and Pythagorean elements.

A search for exact origins of astrology’s development into a complex system remains inconclusive, but the following can be surmised. The combination of Pythagorean theory, such as the supralunary realm influencing the sublunar, Platonic ensouled planets moving on the circle of the Different, Stoic determinism and cosmic sympathy, and the emergence of a Hermetic tradition, comprised the intellectual context for the systematic structuring of astrology, its classifications of the signs, planets, and their placements in a horoscope, and the numerological calculations used for predicting all sorts of events in one’s life.

iv. Plutarch

Besides being a prolific writer on a variety of subjects, Plutarch was, philosophically speaking, a Platonist, as defined by his era, that is, one influenced by Aristotelian, Stoic, and Neopythagorean notions. In Plutarch’s case this includes ideas culled from his study of Persian and Egyptian traditions. By his time (late first century C.E.), astrology had been systematized and appropriated by Greek language and thinking, and in Rome, the political implications of astrological theory were made evident in the relationships between astrologers and emperors (such as Thrasyllus and his son Balbillus) and in the edicts against predictions about emperors (cf. Cramer, 99 ff). Plutarch’s own form of Platonism did not then directly contribute to the technical development of astrology, but it does add a Middle Platonic contribution to an explanation of how astrology gained some credibility and much popularity in the first three centuries of the common era. He also borrowed some astrological concepts (and metaphors) for his own philosophy. First of all, as a priest of Apollo, Plutarch saw all other deities as symbolic aspects of One God that is invisible and unintelligible. He gained impetus for this from an etymology of “Apollo,” which is explained as an alpha-privative a-pollos, or “not many” (De E apud Delphos, 393b). He resists a pure identification of the Sun with Apollo (De pythiae oraculis 400c-d), because the One God is Invisible, and the Sun an intelligible copy. He likens the Sun to one aspect, that of the Nous, the heart of the cosmos. The Moon is then associated with the cosmic Soul (and spleen), and the earth with the bowels. Taking cue from Plato’s suggestion in the Laws (10.896 ff) of two world souls, beneficent and malevolent (a concept Numenius would take up later), he believed the malevolent soul to be responsible for irrational motion in the sublunary world. The malevolent or irrational soul preexisted the demiurge’s creation. It is not pure evil, but the cause of evil operating in the sublunary realm, mixing with the good to create cosmic tension. Plutarch maintains the distinction of Ocellus between the generating supralunary realm and the generated sublunary realm, but he offers more detail about operations in the sublunary world of change. He posits two opposing principles or powers of good and evil that offer a right-handed straight path and a reversed, backwards path for souls (De Isis., 369e). Individual souls are microcosms of a world soul (based on Timaeus, 30b), and the parts of the soul reflect this cosmic tension. Souls are subject in the sublunary realm to a mixture of fate (heimarmenê), chance (tukhê), and free choice (eph’ hêmin). The “young gods”, the planetary gods in the Timaeus (42d-e) that steer souls, Plutarch designates as the province of the irrational soul. With the emphasis of the irrational soul and the mixture of forces in the sublunary realm, Plutarch’s cosmology allows for the possibility of astrology. Plutarch also posits four principles (arkhê) in the cosmos, Life, Motion, Generation and Decay (De genio Socratis, 591b). Life is linked to Motion through the activity of the Invisible, through the Monad; Motion is linked to Generation through the Mind (Nous); and Generation is linked to Decay through the Soul. The three Fates (Moirai) are also linked to this cycle as Clotho seated in the Sun presided over the first process, Atropo, seated in the Moon, over the second, and Lachesis over the third on Earth (cf. De facie in orbe lunae, 945c-d). At death the soul of a person leaves the body and goes to Moon, the mind leaves the soul and goes to Sun. The reverse process happens at birth. Plutarch is not rigid with his use of planetary symbolism, for in another place, he associates the Sun with the demiurge, and the young gods with the Moon, emphasizing the rational and irrational souls (De E apud Delphos, 393a).

Plutarch’s own opinion about astrology as a practice of prediction is ambiguous at best. He supported the probability of divination by human beings, although dimmed by the interference of the body, as evident in his arguments for it in On the E at Delphi (387) and in De defectu oraculorum (431e ff). However, he complains about generals who rely more heavily on divination than on counselors experienced in military affairs (Marius, 42.8). In his accounts of astrologers, his attitude appears to be more skeptical. InRomulus (12), he discusses the claims made by an astrologer named Taroutios, namely, of discovering the exact birth date and hour of Romulus as well as the time in which he lay the first stone of his city, by working backwards from his character to his birth chart. Plutarch considered astrologers’ claims that cities are subject to fate accessible by a chart cast for the beginning of their foundation to be extravagant. He also wrote about how Sulla, having consulted Chaldaeans, was able to foretell his own death in his memoirs (Sulla, 37.1). However, Plutarch finds himself at a loss at explaining why Marius would be successful in his reliance on divination while Octavius was not so fortunate accepting the forecasts of Chaldaeans.

4. The Astrologers

a. The Earliest Hellenistic Astrology: Horoscopic and Katarchic

Cicero’s account in On Divination of Eudoxus’ rejection of Chaldaean astrological predictions points to Greek awareness of Babylonian astrology as early as the third century B.C.E. Another account about Theophrastus’ awareness of Chaldaean horoscopic astrology (predicting for individuals rather than weather and general events) is given to us by Proclus (In Platonis Timaeum commentaria, 3.151). Technical manuals by Greek-speaking astrologers used for casting and interpreting horoscopic (natal) charts date as early as the late second century B.C.E. In addition to natal astrology, many of the fragments exemplify the practice of katarchical astrology, or the selection of the most auspicious moment for a given activity. Katarkhê was also used to ascertain events that had already happened, to view the course of an illness, or track down thieves, lost objects, and runaway slaves. Fragments attributed to Thrasyllus, the philosopher-astrology include such methods. This use of astrology implies that the astrologers themselves did not prescribe to strict fatalism, at least the kind that dictates that knowledge from signs of the heavens cannot influence events. Perhaps like Plutarch, they believed in a combination of fate, chance, and free will. Given the pervasiveness of cosmic sympathy and a unified cosmic order, astrology pertaining to proper moments of time and to natural occurrences was less controversial than that pertaining to the soul of human beings. However, the texts of the next few centuries focus primarily on natal rather than katarchic astrology. Methods to ascertain controversial matters such as one’s length of life would proliferate and play a significant part in Roman politics (cf. Cramer, p. 58 ff). Such fascination with either the fate or predisposition of individuals reflects a stronger concern in the late Hellenistic world for the life of the individual in a period of rapid political and social change.

b. Earliest Fragments and Texts

The earliest Hermetic writings, the technical Hermetica (dated second century B.C.E. and contrasted with philosophical Hermetica cf. Fowden, p. 58) include works on astrology. As mentioned by Clement, (Stromata, 6.4.35-7), they include: on the ordering of the fixed stars, on the Sun, Moon and five planets, on the conjunctions and phases of the Sun and Moon, and on the times when the stars rise. These topics in the early Hermetica do not reflect much technical sophistication in comparison to the complicated techniques of prediction that we find in the katarchic and natal astrology texts of other astrological writers. The astronomical measurements that appear to be used for these topics are most likely for the purpose of katarchic astrology and ritual because they do not contain the apparatus for casting natal charts. An exception to the technical sparsity of astrology considered to be in the lineage of Hermes Trismegistus are the works attributed to Nechepso and Petosiris (typically dated around 150 B.C.E.), portions of which survive in quotations. Combined, they are considered a major source for many later astrologers, and are said by Firmicus Maternus to be in line with the Hermetic tradition, handed down by way of other Hermetic figures such as Aesclepius and Anubio, from Hermes himself. It is impossible to say to what extent the writers of these texts had organized existing techniques or invented new ones, but based on the frequency with which Nechepso and Petosiris are quoted by later authors, we can be certain that they were important conveyers of technical Hellenistic astrology. More about the astral theories in the later philosophical Hermeticism and Gnosticism will be discussed below.

Additional fragments are preserved of real and pseudepigraphical astrologers of the first centuries B.C.E and C.E. including Critodemus, Dorotheus of Sidon, Teukros of Babylon, (pseudo-)Eudoxus, Serapion, Orpheus, Timaeus Praxidas, Anubion, (pseudo-)Erasistratus, Thrasyllus, and Manilius. Only a few representative writers will be highlighted below.

c. Manilius

For most of the early astrological writers, we can only speculate about their theoretical justification for the practice, two exceptions being first century B.C.E. Roman Stoic Manilius, (from whom we have the Latin didactic poem, Astronomica), and Thrasyllus, whose work is described above. Manilius was also associated with the Roman imperial circle, dedicating his work to either Augustus or Tiberius (see Cramer, p. 96, for more on this controversy). While his poetic account of astrology contains much technical material, there is little evidence to show that he himself practiced astrological prediction. Some scholars speculated that he intended to avoid the political dangers of the practice in his day with the poetic writing style and the exclusion of astrological doctrine about the planets, which is necessary for the practice (or his work could simply be incomplete). His Stoic philosophy is one in which Fate is immutable, and astrology is a means of understanding the cosmic and natural order of all things, but not of changing events. However fated we are, he says, is no excuse for bad behavior such as crime, for crime is still wicked and punishable no matter what its origin in the sequence of causal determinism (4.110-117). He used the regularity of the rising of the fixed stars and the courses of the Sun and Moon as proof against the Epicureans that nothing is left to chance and that the universe is commanded by a divine will (1.483-531). Nature apportions to the stars the responsibility over the destinies of individuals (3.47-58). Nature is not thought to be separate from reason, but is the agent of Fate – one orchestrated by a material god for reasons not readily accessible to the mortals who experience apparent injustices and turns of events that defy normal expectations (4.69-86). The purpose of the deity is simply to maintain order and harmony in its cosmos (1.250-254). Astrology demonstrates cosmic sympathy among all things and can be used to predict events insofar as it grants access to the predestined order. In addition to the use of astrology for psychological acceptance of one’s fate, Manilius emphasizes the aesthetic and religious benefits of its study, for he considers it a gift to mortals from the god Hermes for the sake of inducing reverence and piety of the cosmic deity.

d. Claudius Ptolemy of Alexandria

Astrology had increased in popularity in the second century C.E., and two writers of this period operating under different philosophical influences, Ptolemy (c. 100-170 C.E.) and Vettius Valens (fl. 152-162 C.E.), will next be discussed. Ptolemy is an exception among the astrological authors because first and foremost he is an empirical scientist, and one who, like his philosophical and scientific contemporaries, is concerned with theories of knowledge. His works include those on astronomy, epistemology, music, geography, optics, and astrology. He is best known as an astronomer for his work Syntaxis mathematica (Almagest), but from the middle ages to present day, his astrological work,Apotelesmatica (or Tetrabiblos as it is more commonly known), has been considered the key representative of Greek astrology, primarily due to its prominence in textual transmission.

Scholars have claimed Ptolemy’s main philosophical influences to be either Peripatetic, Middle Stoic (Posidonius), Middle Platonist (Albinus) or Skeptic (sharing a possible connection with Sextus Empiricus). Any attempts to tie him to a single school would be futile. His eclecticism, though, is by no means an arbitrary amalgam of different schools, but a search for agreements (rather than disagreements sought by the Pyrrhonian Skeptics) and a scientist’s harmony of rationalism and empiricism (cf. Long in Dillon & Long, p. 206-207). His epistemological criteria (in On the Criterion shows only superficial differences with the Skeptics, while he often employs Stoic terminology (such as katalêpsis) without the Stoic technical meanings. He extends the Stoic notion of oikeiôsis (as the manner of familiarity that a Stoic Sage achieves with the cosmos) to the relations of familiarity that planets and zodiac signs share among themselves.

Because Ptolemy deviates significantly from other astrologers in theory and technique, some have doubted that he was a practicing astrologer at all. It is difficult to support this claim when in theTetrabiblos he makes a long argument in favor of astrology and he claims to have better methods than offered by the tradition. It seems best to call him a “revisionist” rather than a “non-astrologer.” His revisions and causal language make his position vulnerable to later attacks by Plotinus and other philosophers. The methods Ptolemy rejects include material that can be traced to the Hermetic Nechepso/Petosiris text, particularly the use of Lots (klêroi) and the division of the chart into twelve places (topoi) responsible for topics in life such as siblings, illness, travel, etc. Lots were points in the chart typically calculated from the positions of two planets and the degree of the ascending sign. He also rejects various subdivisions of the zodiac and nearly all numerologically based methods. He considered these methods to be disreputable and arbitrary because they are removed from the actual observations of planets and stars. (It might be noted here that he also rejects Pythagorean musicology on empirical grounds in his work Harmonica).

Ptolemy says, in the beginning of Book I, that the study of the relations of the planets and stars to one another (astronomy) can be used for the less perfect art of prediction based on the changes of the things they “surround” (tôn emperiekhomenon). He notes that the difficulty of the art of astrological prediction has made critics believe it to be useless, and he argues in favor of its helpfulness and usefulness. He blames bad and false practitioners for the failing of astrology. The rest of the argument involves the natural cosmic sympathy popularized by Posidonius. The influence of the Sun, Moon, and stars on natural phenomena, weather and seasons brings the possibility than men can likewise be affected in temperament due to this natural ambience (ton periekhon). The surrounding conditions of the time and place of birth contribute a factor to character and temperament (as we find earlier in Ocellus). While the supralunary movements are perfect and destined, the sublunary are imperfect, changeable, and subject to additional causes. Natural events such as weather and seasons are less complicated by additional causes than events in the lives of human beings. Rearing, custom, and culture are additional accidental causes that contribute to the destiny of an individual. He seems to encourage critics to allow astrologers to start their predictions with knowledge of these factors rather than do what is called a “cold reading” in modern astrology. The criticism he counters is that of Skeptics such as Sextus Empiricus, who elaborated on earlier arguments from the New Academy, and who argue that an astrologer does not know if they are making predictions for a human or a pack-ass (Adversus mathematicos, 5.94).

Ptolemy’s arguments that astrology is useful and beneficial are the following: 1) One gains knowledge of things human and divine. This is knowledge for its own sake rather than for the purpose of gains such as wealth or fame. 2) Foreknowledge calms the soul. This is a basic argument from Stoic ethics. 3) One can see through this study that there are other causes than divine necessity. Bodies in the heavens are destined and regular, but on earth are changeable in spite of receiving “first causes” from above. This corresponds again to the Neopythagorean Platonism found in Ocellus. These first causes can override secondary causes and can subsume the fate of an individual in the cases of natural disasters. Ptolemy’s attribution of the nature of planets and stars, which is the basis of their benefic or malefic nature, is that, like Ocellus before him, of heating, drying, moistening, and cooling. The stars in each sign have these qualities too based on their familiarity (oikeiôsis) with the planets. Geometrical aspects between signs, which are the basis of planetary relations, are also based on “familiarity” determined by music theory and the masculine or feminine assignment to the signs. He considers the sextile and trine aspects to be harmonious, and the quadrangle and opposition to be disharmonious.

Book 2 of Tetrabiblos includes material on astrological significations for weather, ethnology and astro-chorography. Ptolemy is not the first to delineate an astrological chorography (geographical regions assigned to signs of the zodiac), and his assignments differ significantly from those found in Dorotheus, Teukros, Manilius, and Paulus Alexandrinus. Book 3 and 4 consist of methods of prediction of various topics in natal astrology. Absent in his work is the katarchical astrology found in earlier writers. Ptolemy is the first astrologer to employ Hipparchus’ zodiac modified to account for the “precession of the equinox,” that is, the changing seasonal reference point against the background of the stars. This zodiac uses the vernal equinox as the beginning point rather than the beginning of one of the twelve constellations. (This “tropical” zodiac would become the standard in the Western practice of astrology up to present day. Modern opponents of astrology typically utilize precession – pointing out the fact that zodiac “signs” no longer match with the star constellations.) Other astrologers, including those shortly following Ptolemy, were either not aware of Hipparchus’ observation or did not find it important to make this adjustment. Valens claims to use another method of Hipparchus, but it is debatable whether or not he adjusted his zodiac to the vernal point. Ptolemy had no impact on other astrologers of the second century, likely because his texts were not yet in circulation.

We do not find in Ptolemy’s work the language of signs and astral divination, but a causal language – the relationships between the planets cause natural activity on earth, from weather to seasons to human temperament. However, Ptolemy argues for the fallibility of prediction, and cannot be considered a strict astral determinist for this reason, though he believed that astrology as a tool of knowledge could be made more accurate with improved techniques, closing the gap of fallibility. The idea that stars are causes is not original with Ptolemy, being an acceptable idea to Peripatetic thinkers cued by Aristotle’s eternal circular motions of the heavens as the cause of perpetual generation (On Generation and Corruption (336b15 ff). For Ptolemy, though, this idea as a justification for the practice of astrology was probably filtered through the Peripatetic influenced Neopythagoreans such as Ocellus. Ptolemy’s arguments may have been the target of subsequent attacks by Alexander of Aphrodisias, Plotinus and early Church Fathers.

e. Vettius Valens

The work Anthologiarum of Vettius Valens the Antiochian (written between 152-162 C.E.) is important for a number of reasons. It contains fragments of earlier writers such as Nechepso and Critodemus, and numerous horoscopes important for the study of the history of astronomy. He is also an astrological writer who best exemplifies the details of the practice and the mind of the practitioner. Having traveled widely in search of teachers, he exhibits techniques unavailable in other astrological texts, indicating much regional variety. Among his sources, he mentions the following astrologers and astronomers (in alphabetical order): Abram, Apollinarius, Aristarchus, Asclation, Asclepius, Critodemus, Euctemon, Hermeias, Hermes, Hermippus, Hipparchus, Hypsicles, Kidenas, Meton, Nechepso, Petosiris, Phillip, Orion, Seuthes and Soudines, Thrasyllus, Timaeus, Zoroaster. Valens claimed to have tested the methods and to have the advantage of making judgments about the methods through much toil and experience (cf. 6.9). He occasionally interjects the technical material with reflections about his philosophical convictions. His philosophical leaning is far less complicated than Ptolemy’s, for it is primarily based on Stoic ethics. His association of the Sun with Nous (1.1), for example, exhibits remnants of the Neopythagorean/Middle Platonic roots (see Plutarch), but his conscious justification for astrology is based on Stoicism. That which is in our power (eph’ hêmin), according to Stoic ethics, is how we adapt ourselves to fate and live in harmony with it. Valens argues that we cannot change immutable fate, but we can control how we play the role we are given (5.9). He quotes Cleanthes, Euripides, and Homer on Fate (6.9; 7.3), emphasizing that one must not stray from the appointed course of Destiny. Valens maintains a sense of “astral piety,” treating astrology as a religious practice, exemplified in the oath of secrecy upon the Sun, Moon, planets and signs of the zodiac in his introduction to Book 7. He asks his reader(s) to swear not to reveal the secrets of astrology to the uneducated or the uninitiated (tois apaideutois ê amuêtois), and to pay homage to one’s initial instructor, otherwise bad things will befall them. In Book 5.9, he provides a Stoic argument in favor of prognostication through astrology. He considers the outcomes that Fate decrees to be immutable, and the goddesses of Hope (Elpis) and Fortune (Tukhê) acting as helpers of necessity and enslave men with the desires created by the turns and expectations of fortune. Those however who engage with prognostication have “calmness of soul” (atarakhôn), do not care for fortune or hope, are neither afraid of death nor prone to flattery, and are “soldiers of fate” (stratiôtai tês heimarmenês). While other places, Valens gives techniques for katarchical astrology (5.3; 9.6) he states that no amount of ritual or sacrifice can alter that which is fated in one’s birth chart. He also considers the time of birth to account for dissimilar natures in two children born of the same parents. In keeping with his religious approach to astrology, he treats it as “a sacred and venerable learning as something handed over to men by god so they may share in immortality.” Like Ptolemy, Valens also blames the imperfections of predictions on the astrologers – particularly the inattentiveness and superficiality of some of the learners.

Ptolemy and Valens stand as representatives of astrology in the second century, but their works were not the most prominent. Astrological concepts were also used in magic, Hermeticism, Gnosticism, Gnostic Christian sects such as the Ophites, and by the author of the Chaldaean Oracles. Other known astrologers of the second century include Antiochus of Athens and Manetho (not to be confused with the Egyptian historian). One additional astrologer will be treated for his philosophical position, Firmicus Maternus. Though because he was influenced by Neoplatonic theories, he will be included below in the section on Neoplatonism.

5. The Skeptics

Already mentioned is Pliny’s acceptance of some methods of astrology and rejection of others based on numerology. Similarly mentioned was Ptolemy’s rejection of various methods based on subdivisions of the zodiac and manipulations based on planetary numbers. Both he and Valens, as astrologers, criticized other practitioners for either shoddy methods or deliberate deception, posing their forms of divination as astrology. Valens went so far as to admonish those who dress up their “Barbaric” teachings in calculations as though they were Greek, perhaps in reference to the frequently maligned “Chaldaeans” (Anthologiarum, 2.35). Geminus of Rhodes, an astronomer of the mid-first century B.C.E., accepts some tenets of astrology, particularly the influence of aspects “geometrical relations” of planets, while rejecting others, such as the causal influence of emanations from fixed stars. Midde Stoic Panaetius is also known to have rejected astrology, most likely under the influence of his astronomer friend Scylax, who like other astronomers of the time, attempted to set the practice of astrology apart from astronomy. Arguments against astrology can be grouped into one of two categories (though there are other ways to classify them): ones that deny the efficacy of astrology or astrologers; and ones that admit that astrology “works” but question the morality of the practice. Arguments of the latter type include those that see astrology as a type of practice of living that assumes a strict fatalism. Some of the earliest arguments against astrology were launched by the skeptical New Academy in the second century B.C.E. Arguments against astrology on moral or ethical grounds would proliferate in Christian theologians such as Origen of Alexandria and other Church Fathers. Astrology would become an important issue for Neoplatonists, with some rejecting it and others embracing it, though not within a context of strict fatalism.

a. The New Academy (Carneades)

The earliest arguments against the efficacy of astrology have been traced to the fourth head of the skeptical New Academy, Carneades (c. 213-129 B.C.E.) (cf. Cramer, p. 52-56). As an advocate of free will, primarily against Stoic determinism, Carneades is likely to have influenced other philosophers who have argued against astrology. The arguments by Carneades, who left no writings, have been reconstructed as the following:

Precise astronomical observations at the moment of birth are impossible (and astrological techniques depend on such precision).
Those born at the same time have different destinies (as empirically observed)
Those born neither at the same time or place often share the same death time (as in the case of natural disasters)
Animals born at the same time as humans (according to strict astrological fatalism) would share the same fate.
The presence of diverse ethnicities, customs and cultural beliefs is incompatible with astrological fatalism.

Astrologers would respond to the last argument with the incorporation of astro-geography or astro-chorography (perhaps as early as Posidonius), indicating an astral typology of a people, and used for the purpose of “mundane” astrology, predictions for entire nations, which would also account for the second argument. Astro-chorography can be found as early as Teukros of Babylon and Manilius, but might be traced to Posidonius’ predecessor Cratos of Mallos.

b. Sextus Empiricus

About three centuries later, Pyrrhonian skeptic Sextus Empiricus would elaborate upon these arguments in “Against the Astrologers” (Pros astrologous, Book 5 of Pros mathêmatikous). He first outlines the procedure of drawing a birth chart, and the basic elements of astrology, the places (topoi), the benefic and malefic nature of the planets, and the criteria for determining the power of the planets. He also notes the disagreements among astrologers, particularly regarding subdivisions of the signs, a disagreement also noted by Ptolemy. Sextus first notes typical arguments against astrology: 1) earthly things do not reallysympathize with celestial. He uses an example from anatomy, namely, the head and lower parts of body sympathize because they have unity, and this unity is lacking in celestial/earthly correspondence; 2) It is held that some events happen by necessity, some by chance, some according to our actions. If predictions are made of necessary events, then they are useless; if of chance events, then they are impossible; if of that according to our will (para hêmas), then not predetermined at all. If as he says, these are arguments by the majority, then there was an attack on the theory of cosmic sympathy and on the use of prediction (any form of divination) on events determined by any or all of the three causes. This precludes the possibility that the planets and stars are causes that determine necessity in the sublunary realm, and it presents astrology as a form of strict determinism. Sextus continues by offering a more specific set of criticisms, including the five thought to originate with Carneades. He especially focuses on the inaccuracy of instruments and measurements used for determining either the time of birth or conception. To these criticisms he adds that astrologers associate shapes and characters of men (tas morphas kai ta êthê) with the characteristics of the zodiac signs, and questions, for example, why a Lion could be associated with bravery while an equally masculine animal, the Bull, is feminine in astrology. He also ridicules physiognomic descriptions, such that those who have Virgo ascending are straight-haired, bright-eyed, white-skinned; he wonders if there are no Ethiopian Virgos. Sextus adds the argument that predictions from the alignment of planets cannot be based on empirical observation since the same configurations do not repeat for 9977 years (one calculation of the Great Year. Many such calculations exist in the Hellenistic and Late Hellenistic eras, for the exact length of the cycle was debated).

6. Hermetic and Gnostic Astrological Theories

The “philosophical” Hermetica, texts in the Hermetic tradition that are typically of later origin than the “technical” astronomical and magical fragments, share astrological imagery in common with another heterogeneous group of texts known as “Gnostic.” (See more on Hermeticism and Gnosticism in Middle Platonism and Gnosticism). A factor present in both collections is the role planets and stars play in the cosmologies and eschatologies, one in which the planets and other celestial entities are seen as oppressive forces or binding powers from which the soul, by nature divine and exalted above the cosmo, must break free. Fate (Heimarmenê) plays a major role in the Hermetic texts, and astrology is sometimes taken for granted as knowledge of the Fate by which the mortal part of a human being is subjected to at birth (cf.Stobaei Hermetica, Excerpt VII). The planets are said to be subservient to Fate and Necessity, which are subordinate powers to God’s providence (pronoia). In the Poimandres text, God made man in his own image, but also made a creator god (demiurge) who made seven administrators (the planets) whose government is Fate. Man being two-fold, is both immortal, and above the celestial government, and mortal, so also a slave within the system, for he shares a bit of the nature of each of the planets. At death the soul of the individual who recognizes their immortal, intellectual, and divine self ascends, while gradually surrendering the various qualities accumulated during the descent: the body is given to dissolution; the character (êthos) is yielded to the daimon (cf. Heraclitus, Fr. 119); and through each the seven planetary zones, a portion of the incarnated self that is related to the negative astrological meaning of each planet (e.g., arrogance to the Sun, greed to Jupiter) is given back to that zone. Arriving at the eighth zone, the soul is clothed in its own power (perhaps meaning its own astral body), while it is deified (in God) in the zone above the eighth (some Gnostic texts also refer to a tenth realm). Astrological fatalism, then, is modified by the Platonic immortal soul whose proper place is above the cosmic order. Astrology affects the temperament and life while in the mortal body, but not ultimately the soul. Another Hermetic text that incorporates astrology is the Secret Sermon on the Mount of Hermes to Tat (Corpus Hermeticum, Book XIII). Here the life-bearing zodiac is responsible for creating twelve torments or passions that mislead human beings. These twelve are overcome by ten powers of God, such as self-control, joy and light. In Excerpt XXIII of the Stobaei Hermetica, the zodiac is again thought responsible for giving life (to animals) while each planet contributes part of their nature to human being. In this instance, as well as in Excerpt XXIX, what the planets contribute is not all vice, but both good and bad in a way that corresponds with the nature of each planet in astrological theory. The Discourses from Hermes to Tat is a discussion of the thirty-six decans, a remnant of Egyptian religion, which was incorporated into Hellenistic astrology. The decans are guardian gods who dwell above the zodiac, and added by servants and soldiers that dwell in the aether, they affect collective events such as earthquakes, famines and political upheaval. Furthermore, the decans are said to rule over the planets and to sow good and bad daimons on earth. Although Fate is an integral part of these Hermetic writings, it seems that the transmission of the Hermetic knowledge, which intends to aid the soul to overcome Fate, is for the elect, because most men, inclining towards evil, would deny their own responsibility for evil and injustice (Excerpt VI). This is a rehashing of the Lazy Man Argument used against Stoic determinism, though cast in the light of astral fatalism.

Hippolytus, being mostly informed by Irenaeus, tells us that the Christian Marcion and his followers used Pythagorean numerology and astrology symbolism in their sect, and that they further divided the world into twelve regions using astro-geography (6.47-48). They may have used a table of astro-numerology like that found in Teukros of Babylon. Some Gnostic sects such as the Phibionites, as did the Christian Marcionites associated each degree of the zodiac with a particular god or daimon. Single degrees of the zodiac (monomoiria) were governed by each planets. The astrologers assigned each degree to a planet by various methods as outlined in the compilation of Paul of Alexandria. For the Gnostics, the degrees were hypostatized as beings that did the dirty work of the planets, who themselves are governed by higher beings on the ontological scale as produced by the Ogdoad, and Decade, and Dodecade, and ultimately leading to a cosmic ruler or demiurge, typically called Ialdabaoth, though varying based on the specific version of the cosmo-mythology of each sect. It is likely that the astrologers and the Gnostics did not use these divisions in the zodiac in the same way. Assignment of planets to divisions of the zodiac is typically used in astrology for determining the relative strength of the planets, and in the case of Critodemus (cited in Valens, 8.26), in a technique for determining length of life. The monomoiria may have been used in the Gnostic and/or Hermetic writers for the sake of gaining knowledge of the powers that oppress in order to overcome them.

In the Chaldaean Oracles, a text of the second century and thought to bear the influence of Numenius, one finds a view of the cosmos similar to that found in the Hermetic corpus. However, the divine influences from above are mediated by Hecate, who separates the divine from the earthly realm and governs Fate. Fate is a force of Nature and the irrational soul of a human being is bound to it, but the theurgic practices of bodily and mental purification, utilizing the rational soul, is preparation for the ascent through the spheres, the dwelling place of the intelligible soul and the Father God. The Oracles share with the Gnostic and Hermetic texts a hierarchy of powers including the zodiac, planets and daimons.

7. Neoplatonism and Astrology

Neoplatonism is typically thought to have originated with Plotinus; though his philosophy, like every Late Hellenistic philosophy and religion, did not develop in a vacuum. Plotinus was acquainted with the Middle Platonists Numenius and Albinus, as well as Aristotelian, Neopythagorean, Gnostic, and Stoic philosophies. Numenius (fl. 160-180 C.E.) shares with the Hermetic and Gnostic cosmologies the notion that the soul of human beings descends through the cosmos (through the Gateway of Cancer), loses memory of its divine life, and acquires its disposition from the planets. The qualities of the planets are again astrological, but vary by degree based on the distance from the intelligible realm – at the highest planetary sphere, Saturn confers reason and understanding, while at the lowest, the Moon contributes growth of the physical body. During the ascent, judges are placed at each planetary sphere; if the soul is found wanting, it returns to Hades above the waters between the Moon and Earth, then is reincarnated for ages until it is set right in virtue (based on the Myth of Er in Plato’s Republic 10.614-621).

The cosmological schemes, particularly the ontological hierarchies, in Middle Platonic, Gnostic and Neopythagorean thinkers typically allows for the place of astrology, if not in a strictly deterministic way for the entire human being, for the transcendent soul descends and ascends through the cosmos and one’s own actions determine future ontological status. This context places Neoplatonic philosophy in a difficult relationship with astrology and fatalism. Plotinus is unique in that he reverses the ontological status of the soul and the cosmos, for the All-Soul (World-Soul, Nous) is the creator and governor of the cosmos, but not a part of it. His philosophy, which exalts the soul above the cosmos and above the ordinance of time, forms the basis for some of his arguments against astrology.

a. Plotinus

Plotinus (204-270 C.E.) takes up the issue of astrology in Ennead 3.1 “On Fate,” and in more detail in the later Ennead 2.3, “Are the Stars Causes?” (chronologically, the 52nd treatise, or third from the last). In the first text, Plotinus points out that some hold the belief that the heavenly circuit rules over everything, and the configurations of the planets and stars determine all events within this whole fated structure (3.1.2). He then elaborates upon an astrology based on Stoic cosmic sympathy theory (sumpnoia), in which animals and plants are also under sympathetic influence of the heavenly bodies, and regions of the earth are likewise influenced (3.1.5). Many astrologers divided countries into astrological zones corresponding to zodiac signs (cf. Manilius Astronomica, 4.744-817). Plotinus briefly presents the arguments that for one, this strict determinism leaves nothing up to us, and leaves us to be “rolling stones” (lithous pheromenois – this recalls the rolling cylinder example in Stoicism). Secondly, he says the influence of the parents is stronger on disposition and appearance than the stars. Thirdly, recounting the New Academy argument, he says that people born at the same time ought to share the same fate (but do not). Given this, he does argue that planets can be used for predictive purposes, because they can be used for divination like bird omens (3.1.6; 3.3.6; 2.3.7-8). The diviner, however, has no place in calling them causes since it would take a superhuman effort to unravel the series of concomitant causes in the organism of the living cosmos, in which each part participates in the whole.

In Ennead 2.3, his arguments can be divided into two types, the first being a direct assault against the specific doctrines and language used by astrologers, the second concerning the roles that the stars have on the individual soul’s descent into matter, as he sees in accordance with Plato’s Timaeus and Republic10. In the first set of arguments, Plotinus displays more intimate familiarity with the language of technical astrology. He turns around the perspective of this language from the observer to the view from the planets themselves. He finds it absurd, for instance, that planets affect one another when they “see” one another and that a pair of planets could have opposite affections for one another when in the region of the other (2.3.4). Another example of the switched perspective is his criticism of planetary “hairesis” doctrine, such that each planet is naturally diurnal or nocturnal and rejoices in its chosen domain. He counters that it is always day for the planets. More pertinent to his philosophy, Plotinus then poses questions about the ontological status of the planets and stars. If planets are not ensouled, they could only affect the bodily nature. If they are ensouled, their effects would be minor, not simply due to the great distance from earth, but because their effects would reach the earth as a mixture, for there are many stars and one earth (2.3.12). Plotinus does think planets are ensouled because they are gods (3.1.5). Furthermore, there are no bad planets (as astrologers claim of Mars and Saturn) because they are divine (2.3.1). They do not have in their nature a cause of evil, and do not punish human beings because we have no effect on their own happiness (2.3.2). Countering moral characteristics that astrologers attribute to the zodiac and planets, Plotinus argues that virtue is a gift from God, and vice is due to external circumstances that happen as the soul is immersed in matter (2.3.9; 2.3.14).

Plotinus does concede that just as human beings are double in nature, possessing the higher soul and the lower bodily nature, so are planets. The planets in their courses are in a better place than beings on earth, but they are not themselves completely unchanging, like beings in the realm of Intellect (2.1). In this regard he attempts to square the contribution of the stars to one’s disposition in the Spindle of Fate in Plato’sRepublic 10, to his belief in free will. From the stars we get our character (êthê), characteristic actions (êthê praxeis) and emotions (pathê). He asks what is left that is “we” (hêmeis), and answers that nature gave us the power to govern (kratein) passions (pathôn) (2.3.9). If this double-natured man does not live in accordance with virtue, the life of the intellect that is above the cosmos, then “the stars do not only show him signs but he also becomes himself a part, and follows along with the whole of which he is a part” (2.3.9, tr. Armstrong).

In summary, Plotinus ridicules astrological technical doctrine for what he sees as a belief in the direct causality of the planets and stars on the fate of the individual. He also finds offensive the attribution of evil or evil-doing to the divine planets. However, he does believe that planets and stars are suited for divination because they are part of the whole body of the cosmos, and all parts are co-breathing (sumpnoia) and contribute to the harmony of the whole (2.3.7). The planets do not, then, act upon their own whims and desires.

b. Porphyry

Plotinus’ best-known student, Porphyry of Tyre (c. 232/3-304/5), held quite a different view on astrology. He wrote a lost work on astrology, Introduction to Astronomy in Three Books (the word “astronomy” meaning “astrology”), and put together an Introduction to Ptolemy’s Tetrabiblos (Eisagôgê eis tên Apotelesmatikên tou Ptolemaiou). In this work he heavily draws upon (and in some cases copies directly from) Antiochus of Athens, an astrologer of the late second century C.E. Antiochus’ influence was considerable, and perhaps greater than Ptolemy’s in the third and fourth centuries, since he was referenced by several later astrologers such as Firmicus Maternus, Hephaistion of Thebes, Rhetorius, and the medieval “Palchus.” It may be that Porphyry encountered Antiochus’ work when he studied in Athens under Longinus (another student of Ammonius Saccas) before continuing his Platonic education under Plotinus. Porphyry attempts to reconcile his belief in astrology with the Platonic belief in a free an exalted soul that is separable from the body. As a Pythagorean, Porphyry promoted abstinence from meat and other methods of detachment from the body as promoting virtue and a life of Nous. (cf. Launching Points to the Realm of the Mind; Letter to Marcella;On Abstinence). In an earlier work of which only fragments exist, Concerning Philosophy from Oracles, Porphyry asserts that gods and the demons use observations of the movements of stars to predict events decreed by Fate, a doctrine originating with the Stoics. He claims astrologers are sometimes incorrect in their predictions because they make faulty interpretations (while assuming that the principles of astrology itself are not false) (cf. Amand, p. 165-166; Eusebius Praeparatio evangelica, 6.1.2-5). In another fragment (Stobaeus, 2.8.39-42), Porphyry interprets Plato’s Myth of Er (Republic 10.614-621) as justification for the compatibility of astrology and free choice (Amand, p. 164-165). Before the souls descend to earth, they are free to choose their guardian daimon. When on earth, they are subject to Fate and necessity based on the lot chosen. Porphyry says this is in agreement with the (Egyptian) astrologers who think that the ascending zodiac sign (hôroskopos), and the arrangement of the planets in the zodiac signify the life that was chosen by the soul (Stobaeus, 2.8.39-42). He notes, as does Plotinus (Enn., 2.3.7), that the stars are scribbling on the heavens that give signs of the future. Both Porphyry and Plotinus discuss the Myth of Er and the stars as giving divinatory signs (sêmainô), but Porphyry accepts the astrological tradition filled with complicated calculations and strange language, while Plotinus rejects it.

Porphyry’s Introduction to Ptolemy’s Tetrabiblos contains little content from Ptolemy, and purports to fill in the terminology and concepts that Ptolemy had taken for granted. Porphyry says that by explicating the language in as simple a way as possible, these concepts will become clear to the uninitiated. His great respect for Ptolemy is evident by his other work on the study of Ptolemy’s Harmonics, and by statements that he makes of his debt, but he includes in the compilation numerous techniques that Ptolemy rejected. The debt he may be paying though, may actually be to readers of Plotinus. It may be a response to Plotinus’ criticism of the language of astrology and the belief that stars are causes. Porphyry seems to think that understanding the complicated scientific language will give back the credence to astrology that the naturalistic model by Ptolemy took away (at least for his most respected teacher).

In the Letter to Anebo, Porphyry poses a series of questions about the order of and distinctions between visible and invisible Gods and daimons, and about the mantic arts. He mentions the ability of some to judge, but the configurations of the stars, whether or not divinatory predictions will be true and false, and if theurgic activity will be fruitful or in vain (Epistula ad Anebonem, 2.6c – in reference to katarchical astrology). He also asks about the symbolism of the images of the Sun that change by the hour (these figures are twelve Egyptian forms that co-rise with the ascending signs of the zodiac. The dôdekaôrai. These uneven hours were measured by the time it took for each sign to rise; cf. Greek Magical Papryi, PGM IV 1596-1715). In this work, though, he complains of Egyptian priest/astrologers such as Chaeremon, who reduce their gods to forces of nature, do not allow for incorporeals, and hold to a strict deterministic astral fatalism (Epist. Aneb., 2.13a). Porphyry concludes with questions about the practice of astrologers of finding one’s own daimon, and what sort of power it imparts to us (Epist. Aneb., 2.14a-2.16a; cf. Vettius Valens, Book 3.1; Hephaistion, Apotelesmatica, 13; 20). Again, reconciling his notions of virtue and free will with astrology, he states that if it is possible to know one’s daimon (indicated by the planet derived through a set of rules and designated as the oikodespotês) from the birth chart, then one can be free from Fate. He notes the difficulties and disagreements among astrologers about how to find this all-important indicator. In fact, in Introduction to Ptolemy’s Tetrabiblos (30), he includes a lengthy chapter (again, borrowing from Antiochus of Athens) that explains a method for finding the oikodespotês) and for differentiating this from other ruling planets (such as the kurios and theepikratêtôr). As will be explicated, Iamblichus, who formed his own unique relationship to astrology, answered these questions in his De mysteriis.

c. Iamblichus

While Iamblichus (c. 240-325 C.E.) believed in the soul’s exaltation above the cosmos, he did not, like Plotinus, think that the embodied soul of the human being is capable of rising above the cosmos and its ordering principle of Fate through simple contemplation upon the One, or the source of all things. Iamblichus responds to Porphyry’s accusation that Egyptian religion is only materialistic: just as the human being is double-natured, an incorporeal soul immersed in matter, this duality is replicated at each level of being (5.20). Theurgy, for most people, should begin with the material gods that have dominion over generation and corruption of bodies. He does not think the masses are capable of intellectual means of theurgy (this is reserved for the few and for a later stage in life), but that a theurgist must start at their own level of development and individual inclinations. His complex hierarchy of beings, including celestial gods, visible gods, angels and daimons, justifies a practice of theurgy in which each of these beings is sacrificed and prayed to appropriately, in a manner pleasing to and in sympathy with their individual natures. Material means, i.e., use of stones, herbs, scents, animals, and places, are used in theurgy in a manner similar to magical practices common in the Late Hellenistic era, with the notable difference that they are used simply to please and harmonize with the order of the higher beings, rather than to obtain either an earthy or intellectual desire. Divinity pervades all things, and earthly things receive a portion of divinity from particular gods.

Answering Porphyry’s question about the meaning of the Sun god seated on the Lotus (an Egyptian astrological motif), Iamblichus responds that the images that change with the zodiacal hours are symbolic of an incorporeal (and unchanging) God who is unfolded in the Light through images representing his multiple gifts. His position above the Lotus (which, being circular, represents the motion of the Intellect) indicates his transcendence over all things. Curiously, Iamblichus also says that the zodiac signs along with all celestial motions, receive their power from the Sun, placing them ontologically subordinate to it (De mysteriis, 7.3).

Next addressing Porphyry’s question about astral determinism of Chaeremon (who is thought to be a first century Alexandrian astrologer/priest versed in Stoic philosophy; cf. Porphyry, De abstinentia, 4.6; Origen Contra Celsum, 1.59; Cramer, p. 116-118) and others, Iamblichus indicates that the Hermetic writings pertaining to natal astrology play a minor role in the scope of Hermetic/Egyptian philosophy (De myst., 8.4) Iamblichus does not deny the value of natal astrology, but considers it to be concerned with the lower material life, hence subordinate to the intellectual. Likewise, not all things are bound to Necessity because theurgic exercises can elevate the soul above the cosmos and above Fate (8.7). On Porphyry’s question about finding one’s personal daimon through astrological calculation, Iamblichus responds that the astrological calculations can say nothing about the guardian daimon. Since the natal chart is a matter concerning one’s fatedness, and the daimon is assigned prior to the soul’s descent (it is more ancient; presbutera) and subjection to fate, such human and fallible sciences as astrology are useless in this important matter (9.3-4). In general, Iamblichus does not show much inclination for use of astrological techniques found in Ptolemy, Antiochus, and other astrologers, but he does believe that astrology is in fact a true science, though polluted by human errors (9.4). He also accepts and uses material correspondences to celestial gods (including planets), as well as katarchical astrology, observations used for selecting the proper times (8.4).

d. Firmicus Maternus

Julius Firmicus Maternus was a fourth century Sicilian astrologer who authored an astrological work in eight books, Matheseos, and about ten years later, a Christian polemical work, On the Error of Profane Religions (De errore profanarium religionum). Unlike Augustine (who studied astrology in his youth), Firmicus did not launch polemics against astrology after his conversion to Christianity He is mentioned briefly for his Neoplatonic justification for the practice of astrology. While he claims only meager knowledge in astrology, his arguments betray a passionate commitment to a belief in astral fatalism. He treats astrological knowledge as a mystery religion, and as Vettius Valens did before him, he asks his reader, Mavortius, to take an oath of secrecy and responsibility concerning astrological knowledge. He refers to Porphyry (along with Plato and Pythagoras) as a likeminded keeper of mysteries (7.1.1). In De errore, however, he attacks Porphyry for the same reason, that he was a follower of the Serapis cult of Alexandria (Forbes’ translation, p. 72). Firmicus’ oath is upon the creator god (demiurge) who is responsible for the order of the cosmos and for arranging the planets as stations along the way of the souls’ ascent and descent (7.1.2).

While outlining the arguments of astrology’s opponents, (including the first and second arguments of the New Academy, mentioned above), Firmicus claims not to have made up his mind concerning the immortality of the soul (Matheseos, 1.1.5-6), but he shortly betrays a Platonic belief in an immortal soul separable from the body (1.3.4). These souls follow the typical Middle Platonic ascent and descent through the planetary spheres; as a variation on this theme, he holds the notion that souls descend through the sphere of the Sun and ascend through the sphere of the Moon (1.5.9). This sovereign soul is capable of true knowledge, and, by retaining an awareness in spite of its forgetful and polluted state on Earth, can know Fate imperfectly through the methods of astrology handed down from Divine Mind (mentis treated as a Latin equivalent for nous, 1.4.1-5; 1.5.11). In response to the critics, he suggests that they do not have first hand knowledge and that if they encountered false predictions, the fault lies with the fraudulent pretenders to astrology and not with the science itself (1.3.6-8). For Firmicus, the planets, as administrators of a creator God, give each individual soul their character and personality (1.5.6-7).

After offering profuse praise of Plotinus, Firmicus attacks his belief that everything is in our powers and that superior providence and reason can overcome fortune. He argues that Plotinus made this claim in the prime of his health, but that he too accepted the powers of Fate toward the end of his life, since all efforts to advert poor health, such as moving to a better climate, failed him (1.7.14-18). Following this and other examples offered to his reader of fated events, he argues against the notion held by some, that fate (heimarmenê) only controls birth and death. This argument may be a precursor of the definition of fate that Hierocles offered a century later, which will be discussed next.

e. Hierocles

Hierocles of Alexandria is a fifth century Neoplatonist who argued against astrology, particularly an astrological theory based on a Stoic view of Fate and Necessity. He also rejected magical and theurgical practices prevalent in his time as a way to either escape or overcome the fate set down in one’s birth chart. His argument against these practices is based on his view of Providence and Fate, found in his work On Providence, which only survives in later summaries by ninth century Byzantine Patriarch, Photius. In general, Hierocles saw himself in line with the thinkers starting with Ammonius Saccas, who argue for the compatibility between Plato and Aristotle, while he rejects thinkers who emphasize their differences, such as Alexander of Aphrodisias. His view of Fate is that it is an immutable ordering of thinking according to divine Justice. Using, as do Plotinus and Porphyry, Plato’s Myth of Er (Rep., 10), fate is a system of rewards and punishments the souls choose before reincarnation on earth. He does not, though, like Porphyry, accept the transmigration of the soul from human to animal body and vice versa. This view on reincarnation had already been put forth by Cronius, a contemporary of Numenius (cf. Dillon, p. 380). He considers astrology to be contrary to this notion of Fate because it works by a principle of “mindless necessity” (enepilogiston anagkên). Photius writes of Hierocles:

He does not at all accept the irrational “necessity” spoken of by the astrologers, nor the Stoic “force,” nor even what Alexander of Aphrodisias supposed it to be, who identifies it with the nature of Platonic Bodies. Nor does he accept that one’ birth can be altered by incantations and sacrifices. (Codex 214, 172b, tr. Schibli, p. 333)

The astrological theory he is arguing against is supported by Stoic fate and necessity, which assumes a chain of physical efficient causes. The astrologers who most closely represent this view are Manilius and Vettius Valens (link to above sections). There is nothing in the surviving summary to indicate that Hierocles also argues against the notion of Plotinus and Porphyry that the stars are signs rather than causes, because they are part of the rational and divine order of all things. Since he believed there is nothing outside of rational Providence, including that which is in our power (to eph’ hêmin), the stars too would be a part of the rational ordering. His fate, being quite deterministic but based on moral justice, does not allow for magic and theurgic practices used to exonerate one from his Fate revealed through astrology (cf. Porphyry’s Letter to Anebo; Greek Magic Papyri, XIII, 632-640). These practices he saw as unlawful attempts to manipulate or escape the ordering of things by the Providence of God.

f. Proclus

Proclus (410/11-485) was the director of the Platonic School at Athens, which called itself the “Academy” in order to maintain lineage with Plato’s fourth century school. In the absence of direct statements about the astrology, Proclus’ position on astral fatalism can be surmised through his philosophy, particularly his metaphysical hierarchy of beings. A paraphrase of Ptolemy’s astrological work, Tetrabiblos, is attributed to him, though there is little evidence to make a substantial claim about the identity of the author/copyist. Proclus did, however, take a keen interest in astronomy, and critiqued Ptolemy’s astronomical work,Syntaxis (or Almagest) in his Outline of Astronomical Hypotheses. In this work, he argues against Ptolemy’s theory of precession of the equinox (Hyp. astr., 234.7-22), although other Plato/Aristotle synthesizers, such as Simplicius, accepted it along with the additional spheres the theory would entail beyond the eighth (the fixed stars).

Proclus generally proposed three levels of being – celestial, earthly, and in-between. The four elements exist at every level of being, though fire (in the form of light) predominates in the celestial realm. Celestial beings are independent, self-subsistent, divine, and have their own will and power. As ensouled beings, celestial bodies are self-moving (the Platonic notion of soul). In order to maintain a consistency with Platonic doctrine, he argued against the notion that celestial spheres are solid paths upon which the planets and stars are carried along. Rather they are places possessing latitude, longitude, and depth (bathos – a measure of proximity to earth), which are projected by the free planets as their potential course. As visible gods, he thought the planets to be intermediaries between the intelligible realm and the sensible. In terms of planets being causes, he accepts the Aristotelian notion that they cause physical changes below (due to heat and light). However, he also accepted another type of non-physical causality, more akin to cosmic sympathy, in which several causes come together to form a single effect at a proper time and place. Everything lower in the hierarchy is dependent upon the higher, and is given its proper lot (klêros) and signature (sunthêma) of the higher beings. The celestial gods also have a ruling power over lower beings (Institutio theological, 120-122). This notion of properness (epitêdeiotês) extends from the celestial realm to all things below, including plants and metals (cf. Siovanes, p. 128-129). This is much akin to astrological theory, in which each planet and sign contributes, in varying proportions, to a single effect, the individual. The planetary gods are not the only actors, for they have invisible guardians (doruphoroi – not to be confused with the planets who guard the Sun and the Moon in astrological doctrine) who populate that the space of the planets’ courses, and who act as administrators. Proclus, though, is not a strict astral determinism, for as a theurgist, he also thought these allotments can be changed through theurgic knowledge (In Platonis Timaeum commentaria, 1.145).

8. Astrology and Christianity

Astrology’s relationship with early Christianity has a very complex history. Prior to being established as the official religion of the Roman Empire, the attitude of Jews and Christians toward astrology varied greatly. Philo of Alexandria and various Jewish pseudepigraphical writers condemned the practice of astrology (1 Enoch, Sibylline Oracles), while other texts accept portions of it and depict biblical figures such as Abraham and Noah as astrologers (cf. Barton, Ancient Astrology, p. 68-70). As mentioned above, early Christians such as Marcion and Basilides incorporated some aspects of astrology into their belief systems. In general, though, for the earliest Christian polemicists and theologians, astrology was incompatible with the faith for a number of reasons, mostly pertaining to the immorality of its fatalism. Some of the Christian arguments against astrology were borrowed from the skeptical schools. Hippolytus of Rome (170-236 C.E.) dedicating nearly an entire book (4) of his Refutations Against All Heresies, closely followed the detailed arguments from Sextus Empiricus, particularly concerning the lack of accurate methods for discerning the time of birth, which is required for establishing the natal chart. He is particularly troubled by the associations between signs of the zodiac and physiognomical features. Hippolytus outlines a list very similar to that of Teukros of Babylon (as contained in the latter’s De duodecim signis) containing correspondences between physiological and psychological characteristics; and he argues that the constellations were merely markers for star recognition, bear no resemblance to the animals by which they are named, and can bear no resemblance to human characteristics (Refutatio omnium haeresium, 4.15-27).

Bardaisan/Bardesanes (c 154-222 C.E.) was a converted Syriac Christian, who, like Augustine, studied astrology in his youth. It appears that in his conversion he did not give up all astrological thinking, for he accepts the role of the planets and stars as administrators of God. He wrote against astro-chorography, particularly the association of regions with planets based on seven climata or zones, stating that laws and customs of countries are based on institution of human free will and not on the planets. Along with free will, though, he accepts a degree of governance of nature and of chance, indicated by the limit of things in our control. Bardesanes is thought to be a forerunner of Mani, for he accepted a dualism of two world forces, dark and light (cf. Rudolf, Gnosis, p. 327-329).

Origen of Alexandria’s (185-254 C.E.) relationship to astrology was equally, if not more, complex than that of Plotinus. In his Commentary on Genesis he, in a manner similar to Plotinus, offers arguments against stars as causes, but in favor of stars as signs, divine writings in the sky. These writings are available for divine powers to gain knowledge and to participate in the providential aide of human beings (Philocalia, 23.1-23.21; cf. Barton, Power and Knowledge, p. 63-64). Origen believed that all beings, celestial, human or in-between, have the role of helping all creatures attain salvation. Celestial beings play a particular role in this cosmological paideia of educating creatures toward virtue. These signs, however, are imperfect at the human level, and cannot give exact knowledge (Philocalia, 23.6). Elsewhere (De oratione, 7.1), Origen urges us to pray for the Sun, Moon and stars (rather than to them), for they are also free beings (so he surmises by interpreting Psalm 148:3) and play a unique role in the salvation of the cosmos. Quite uniquely, Origen also appears to have been one of the first philosophers (if not the first) to use the theory of precession of the equinox as an argument against astrological prediction (Philocalia, 23.18).

Origen argued against those in antiquity who interpreted the Star of Bethlehem as an astrological prediction of the birth of Christ made by the Chaldaeans. He first notes that the Magi (from Persia) are to be distinguished from Chaldaeans (a word which at the time generally referred to Babylonian astrologers or simply astrologers). Secondly, he argues that the star was unlike any other astral phenomenon they had observed, and they perceived that it represented someone (Christ) superior to any person known before, not simply by the sign of the star, but by the fact that their usual sorcery and knowledge from evil daimons had failed them (Contra Celsum, 59-60). In general, regardless of the intentions of the gospel writers of including the myth of the Star of Bethlehem, it was interpreted by Christians not as a prediction by astrological methods of divination, but as a symbol of Christ transcending the old cosmic order, particularly fate oppressing the divinely granted human free will, and replacing it with a new order (cf. Denzey, “A New Star on the Horizon,” in Prayer, Magic, and the Stars, p. 207-221).

Three fourth century theologians, Gregory of Nyssa, Gregory Nazianzen, and Basil, known as the Cappadocians, rejected astrology as a part of an overall rejection of irrational Chance (Tukhê) and deterministic Necessity (Anankê) (see Pelikan, p. 154-157). Random chance had no place in the economy of God’s universe, while blind necessity denies human free will. They differentiated astrology from astronomy, which was an appropriate study for admiration of creation. Unlike Origen and Plotinus, Gregory Nazianzen rejected the notion of that stars give signs for reading the future. He feared that those who interpret the biblical notion that the stars were created for giving signs (Genesis 1:14) would use this as justification for horoscopic astrology (Pelikan, p. 156).

In the Latin west, Augustine (354-430 C.E.) took up polemics against astrology in conjunction with his arguments against divination (De civitate dei, 5.1-7). His distain for astrology is related to his early exposure to it as a Manichean prior to his conversion to Christianity. In De civitate dei (City of God), he borrowed freely from Cicero’s arguments against Stoic fate and divination. He particularly elaborated upon the New Academy argument that people born at the same time having different destinies (the twin argument). He includes in his attack on astrology the futility of katarchic astrology (choosing the proper moments for activities) as well as its contradiction with deterministic natal astrology. If persons are predestined by their natal charts, how can they hope to change fate by choosing the proper time for marriage, planting crops, etc? In addition, he attributes correct predictions by astrologers to occasional inspiration of evil daimons rather than the study of astrological techniques (De civ., 5.7).

As Christianity gained political and cultural ascendancy, decrees against astrology multiplied. With the closing of the “pagan” schools in 529, Neoplatonists and the astrology attached to them fled to Persia. Substantial debate exists about whether or not they set up a new school in Persia, specifically Harran, and likely, later, in Baghdad; but one thing that is certain is that astrological texts and astronomical tables (such as the Pinax of Ptolemy) used for casting charts were translated into Persian and adjusted for the sixth century. The astrological writings, particularly of Ptolemy, Dorotheus, and Vettius Valens, were then translated into Arabic and would become a part of Islamic philosophy. The Greek texts, in combination with developments in Persia and the astrology of India, would form the basis of medieval astrology. Astrology from that point on would continued its unique history, both combining with and striving against philosophical and scientific theories, up to the present day.

9. References and Further Reading

Amand, David. Fatalisme et Liberté dans L’Antiquité Grecqué (Lovain: Bibliothèque de L’Université, 1945)
Barton, Tamsyn. Ancient Astrology (London: Routledge, 1994)
Barton, Tamsyn. Power and Knowledge: Astrology, Physiognomics, and Medicine under the Roman Empire (Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press, 1994)
Bobzien, Susanne. Determinism and Freedom in Stoic Philosophy (Oxford University Press, 1998)
Catalogus Codicum Astrologorum Graecorum, ed. D. Olivieri, et al., 12 Volumes (Brussels: Academie Royale, 1898-1953)
Cramer, Frederick H. Astrology in Roman Law and Politics (Philadelphia: American Philosophical Society, 1959)
Denzey, Nicola. “A New Star on the Horizon: Astral Christologies and Stellar Debates in the Early Christian Discourse,” in Prayer, Magic, and the Stars, ed. Scott B Noegel (University Park, PA: Pennsylvania University Press, 2003).
Dillon, John. The Middle Platonists (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1977)
Dillon, John and A. A. Long, eds. The Question of “Eclecticism”: Studies in Later Greek Philosophy(Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1988)
Edelstein, L. and I. G. Kidd, eds. Posidonius: I. The Fragments (Cambridge University Press, 1972)
Firmicus Maternus, The Error of the Pagan Religions, tr. Clarence A. Forbes (NY: Newman Press, 1970)
Firmicus Maternus. Mathesis, Vol. I and II, ed. W. Kroll and F. Skutsch (Stuttgart: Teubner, 1968)
Firmicus Maternus, Matheseos Libri VIII, tr. Jean Rhus Bram (Park Ridge, NJ: Noyes Press, 1975)
Fowden, Garth. Egyptian Hermes (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1986)
Green, William Chase. Moira: Fate, Good, & Evil in Greek Thought (Harper & Row, 1944)
Gundel, W. and Gundel, H. G. Astrologumena: die astrologische Literatur in der Antike und ihre Geschichte (Wiesbaden: Franz Steiner Verlag GMBH, 1966)
Holden, James Herschel. A History of Horoscopic Astrology (Tempe, AZ: American Federation of Astrologers, Inc, 1996)
Hunger, Hermann, and David Pingree. Astral Science in Mesopotamia (Leiden: Brill, 1999).
Iamblichus. On the Mysteries, tr. Thomas Taylor (San Francisco: Wizards Bookshelf, 1997)
Layton, Bentley, tr. and ed. The Gnostic Scriptures (New York: Doubleday, 1987).
Long, A. A. ed. Problems in Stoicism (London: Athlone Press, 1971).
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Author Information

Marilynn Lawrence
Email: pronoia@nni.com
West Chester University of Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

Solomon Maimon (1753—1800)

maimon The enigmatic philosopher, Solomon Maimon, is an important figure in the development of the movement referred to today as German Idealism. Immanuel Kant recognized Maimon as the critic who perhaps best understood his Critique of Pure Reason, and Fichte praises Maimon, wondering if later generations will look down on his own generation for having dismissed Maimon. Although Maimon is important in the development of post-Kantian German philosophy, he was largely ignored during his day and despite some attention by later German philosophers, he has remained largely unknown. This is more than likely due to the fact that his works are quite complex and lacking in systematicity, as well as due to the fact that German was not his first tongue and to the fact that he had a somewhat difficult personality. In the twenty-first century, his writings are receiving significantly more attention.

Maimon’s Life and Works
The Problem of the Quid Juris
The Thing-in-Itself and the Doctrine of Differentials
The Thing-in-Itself and The Infinite Understanding
Intuition
Skepticism and the Quid Facti
Transcendental Logic
The Principle of Determinability
Ethics and Legal Theory
Maimon’s Influence
References and Further Reading

1. Maimon’s Life and Works

Although there are some disputes about the year of Maimon’s birth, the accepted view is that he was born in 1753 near Sukoviborg (near Mir), Lithuania, in what is today Belarus. Solomon Maimon was not his given name at birth; rather, he was known as Shlomo ben Joshua. At around eleven years of age, he married and by the time he was fourteen, he was already a father. Beginning early in his life, he received training in Talmudic studies and became familiar with the Kabbalah as well as Hasidic texts and he came to revere Maimonides’ Guide to the Perplexed, a text that had great influence on him. In fact, when he changed his name in order to follow western European conventions, he adopted the surname of “Maimon” of out reverence for the great medieval Jewish philosopher. Feeling the need in his mid-twenties to study more science and philosophy, Maimon left his family behind and went West. He stopped briefly in Berlin but was not allowed to enter the city. For almost two years after his explusion from Berlin, Maimon lived as a beggar before settling in Posen and receiving a job as a tutor. He later left for Berlin again and was allowed into the city this time. He became friends with Moses Mendelssohn and other Jewish intellectuals, who, despite Maimon’s bad German and his lack of social graces, tolerated him because they recognized that he possessed a very sharp intellect. Maimon traveled again, staying for a short time in Amsterdam. Finding the Jewish community there to be too bourgeois for him in its tastes and interests, he returned to Germany. Maimon settled in Hamburg where he entered a high school (most likely between 1783-85) and pursued studies to improve his knowledge of math, science, and the German language. Matriculation records from a German high school (a “Gymnasium”) list a Solomon Maimon among its pupils, so it is likely that Maimon began referring to himself with this name and not “Shlomo ben Joshua” during this stay in Germany

It was after this period that Maimon began his philosophical writings. He moved from Hamburg to Breslau (Wroclaw) and took up a position as a tutor with a family. He wrote several textbooks in Hebrew, one on math and one concerned with Newton’s physics. He also translated Moses Mendelssohn’s Morgenstunden into Hebrew. At the end of the decade, Maimon traveled to Berlin yet again. It was at this point that he began his study of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason. Kant’s friend, Marcus Herz, who was also a friend of Maimon’s, sent Kant Maimon’s draft of a commentary on the first Critique. Kant had no intention of reading through the commentary because he found himself too busy with other work. Yet, he later commented to Herz that a brief look through Maimon’s manuscript showed him that Maimon had understood the first Critique better than all of Kant’s other critics. With Kant’s “accolade” in hand, Maimon attained a legitimacy that opened several doors and publishing avenues for him. Maimon revised the manuscript and published it in 1790 as Versuch über die Transcendentalphilosophie, mit einem Anhang über die symbolische Erkenntnis und Anmerkungen [Essay on Transcendental Philosophy with an Appendix on Symbolic Knowledge, and Notes]. (Hereafter, this text will be cited as the “Versuch”)]. On the whole, the work is a set of criticisms of Kant’s first Critique but it also interspersed with criticisms of or elaborations on Maimon’s own commentary on Kant.. Between 1791 and 1800, Maimon went on to write nine other books and numerous articles published in some of the more prominent German-language journals of the day. Maimon lived in poverty for most of the early part of the 1790’s. For the last five years of his life, he was supported by Adolf von Kalkreuth, a noble with considerable interest in philosophy. Maimon lived on von Kalkreuth’s estate near Glogow, in what is today southwestern Poland. Maimon died on 22 November 1800. Supposedly, the Jewish citizens of Glogow disapproved of Maimon for not being a pious Jew and he was not allowed to be buried within the Jewish cemetery.

Maimon claims that there were several phases to his philosophical development. The first – and perhaps most important stage – was Maimon’s early encounter with Maimonides’ Guide to the Perplexed. It is because of Maimonides that Maimon falls under the spell of rationalistic schools of thought. Not only does Maimon obtain from Maimonides the idea that philosophy – and furthermore, human existence – should be about the attainment of truth, but he also takes from Maimonides the belief that religion and its doctrines must be consistent with philosophy. As will become evident from what is written below, many of the doctrines to which Maimon professes can be traced back to Maimonides. Secondly, in his early visits to Berlin, Maimon comes into contact with other, more recent thinkers also in the rationalistic tradition: the Leibnizian-inspired philosopher Christian Wolff, Leibniz, and Spinoza. At that time in Germany, Spinoza was seen as a very dangerous figure because the accepted view of his philosophy was that it necessarily led to atheism. Maimon disagreed and had a significant respect for Spinoza. Finally, Maimon came upon Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason in early 1787 and was awed by it. It was probably at this time that Maimon came into contact with English empiricism, and Hume in particular. As will be discussed below, a very important strand of Maimon’s thought is occupied with Humean skepticism. However, scholars differ as to whether or not skepticism ends up being Maimon’s settled view.

It is difficult to summarize Maimon’s views given that none of his works is systematic and that his views evolved somewhat over the 10 year period in which he was publishing his writings. In fact, it is this lack of systematicity – as well as Maimon’s German, which at times is extremely unclear – that has contributed to Maimon’s lack of recognition. Often his texts read like conglomerations of stream-of-consciousness thoughts, albeit very perceptive ones. He does, however, give a clue about his philosophy as a whole when he describes his thought as a “coalition system” [Koalitionssystem] in which he attempts to incorporate the main ideas of previous schools of thought or important thinkers. The extent to which these ideas actually can be made to fit into a coherent system is open for debate. Likewise, there is question among the scholars as to which school of thought Maimon ultimately sides. The question is not easily resolved.

Maimon’s work was only rediscovered in the mid-1800’s and it just beginning to receive the attention that it deserves. Until recently, he has achieved more notoriety because of his Autobiography, originally published in 1792-93, the first part of which is currently available in English. The book is noteworthy because, in addition to documenting Maimon’s travels and tribulations, it provides one of the very earliest depictions of life in an Eastern European Jewish community, a “stetl.” Despite the historical and “sociological” significance of this Autobiography, he should be seen first and foremost as a philosopher. Kant recognized Maimon’s talents and saw that Maimon was one of the few who seemed to understand the project of the first Critique. Due to the similarity of themes on which Maimon wrote in his Versuch über die Transcendentalphilosophie and themes that Kant addresses in the Critique of Judgment (1790), it is possible that Maimon’s thought had some influence on doctrines that Kant brings forth in this Critique. Fichte mentions Maimon by name in many places in his early work and there is no doubt that some of his doctrines are responses to Maimon’s view. In fact, Maimon is one of the first philosophers of that era to take the history of philosophy seriously and to attempt to show how his views are, in a certain respect, the culmination of developments within the evolution of philosophical thought. In order to understand the development of German Idealism, one must understand where Maimon fits into the movement. Maimon, however, merits attention for being more than just an important, yet underappreciated figure in the development of German Idealism. In particular, his worries about the gap between the quid juris and the quid facti need to be applied to all of the philosophies in the movement. It is not clear if any of the major figures of German Idealism – Fichte, Schelling, or Hegel – ultimately can or do give adequate responses to the problem of the quid juris. More importantly, these worries can be extended to any type of systematic philosophy or rationalistic system of thought. Maimon calls our attention to the fact that it is not enough if a system, a philosophical or scientific system for example, is internally coherent. Internal coherence only gives an answer to the question of the quid juris. What still needs to be shown is not simply how it is possible for such a system to map onto our empirical world, but that the given system does, in fact, map onto the world. Another way of looking at the issue is that Maimon is concerned with the status of science, in the broadest connotation of “science.” It is not enough for science to provide us with a good story or a coherent story about how the world is. Instead, science must give the correct story about how the world is and one that can completely justify its claims. The problem is – and here we return to the gap between the quid juris and the quid facti – science is still only giving us a good or seemingly accurate story.

2. The Problem of the Quid Juris

Unfortunately, even given the stir that Kant’s first Critique caused when it was first published in 1781 and then again revised in 1787, philosophers and critics more often than not either misinterpreted Kant or simply did not understand his views. In the Versuch über die Transcendentalphilosophie, Maimon was able to put his finger on the heart of the problem of the whole of the Transcendental Analytic division of the first Critique. Maimon focused on the notorious “Transcendental Deduction of the Categories” section, in which Kant attempts to justify how intellect and sensation can be combined into cognition. This is the question of the “quid juris,”as Kant calls it. In short, what is at issue is not an actual demonstration that the intellect and sensation actually do combine to form a cognition – this is an issue of fact or the quid factis, as Kant labels it – but a demonstration of how it is possible for them to come together in a cognition. Maimon, unlike other Kant critics of the day and even many Kant supporters, astutely recognizes how central this issue is to Kant’s whole critical project. He understands that Kant is not trying to show that intellect and sensation actually do come together but rather that Kant wants to provide a justification for how it is possible that sensation and intellect can come together. As a result, Maimon makes this issue of the quid juris – and the related issue of the quid facti – a centerpiece of many of his own writings throughout his career. He actually sees the issue in terms of the broader problem of mind and body interaction. Thus, for Maimon the issue actually becomes how we are to be justified in thinking that mind – something supposedly non-physical and non-spatial – can interact with body, something physical and spatial. Kant tried to occupy a middle ground between the rationalist and empiricist schools and, thus, ends up maintaining that the form of cognition was a priori and came from the understanding, whereas the content of cognition was a posteriori, coming from sensation (or “intuition,” in Kant’s language) and, thus, the physical side. Maimon, like many contemporary Kant critics, holds that the section of the Transcendental Analytic referred to as the “Schemata,” is that section of the first Critique in which Kant tries to give his answer to the quid juris. Simply put, on this reading of the first Critique, it is in the very nature of time, as a schema of concepts, that the link between the a priori concepts of the understanding and the a posteriori given content from intuition is supposedly found.

Maimon disagrees. He maintains that if mind and body, or intellect and intuition, are two radically different sources of knowledge as Kant wants to maintain, then ultimately they can never to come together because they are so radically different by definition. In other words, if intellect and intuition are so different, as Kant wants to hold, then Kant already make it impossible for these two stems of knowledge to be unified. In contrast, Maimon’s claims that the only way in which intellect and intuition can be united is if they are of similar origin. Thus, he holds that the only solution to the quid juris is to assume that intellect and intuition must be alike. He does not follow along empiricist lines where concepts are but abstractions from sensations. Rather, he turns to the Leibniz-Wolff school for his solution to the problem. Maimon claims that, ultimately, sensation – or intuition, as Kant terms it – has its root in the understanding. For Leibniz and Wolff, sensation or intuition simply amounts to a confused form of conceptual knowledge; Maimon concurs.

3. The Thing-In-Itself and the Doctrine of Differentials

In Kant’s system, the form of our knowledge is a priori and arises out of the nature of the understanding and the forms of intuition that we – as humans – possess are also a priori.. The content of our knowledge, at least of our empirical knowledge, comes from outside of us. Or, to be more precise, this material of our knowledge is the result of our intuitive faculty being affected by something outside of it. This “something” is none other than Kant’s notion of the thing-in-itself, an infamous tenet of Kant’s system. The problem is that Kant must rely on this idea of a thing-in-itself in order to account for what gives rise to our empirical knowledge. Unfortunately, we cannot know – in Kant’s formal definition of what it is “to know” – the thing-in-itself because knowledge for Kant always entails a combination of concepts and matter or content. In Kant’s system, we are forbidden from employing or extending categories beyond that of which we have intuition; this, in Kant’s system, would involve an illegitimate use of the categories. Hence, the thing-in-itself becomes problematic because, in Kant’s system, one is left in the situation that one can only speculate about, but not know, things-in-themselves. Furthermore, Kant must posit things-in-themselves because their existence ultimately plays the role of a criterion of truth in his system. The world of our sense experience, as opposed to, say, a world of our dreams, is real for Kant because the content of our sense experience ultimately refers back to something real: The thing-in-itself. This is what allows Kant to claim that “experience” has some foundation and is not just an illusion or chimera.

There are, however, two problems. First, knowledge – in Kant’s sense of the term – requires things-in-themselves but the very positing of things-in-themselves appears to be a contradiction because this seems to involve the extension of concepts to realms into which they are allowed to be extended. That is, in order to cognize things-in-themselves we must use concepts and discursive or conceptually-based knowledge. But things-in-themselves, by their very nature, are supposed to stand outside of conceptual knowledge. Second, and more seriously, the doctrine of things-in-themselves does not help to resolve the matter of the quid juris. That issue, as it will be remembered, concerns our justification for assuming that elements of cognition that arise out of the intellect can possibly be combined together with elements of cognition that arise empirically from the senses, or intuition, to use Kantian terminology. But if things-in-themselves stand beyond our ability to cognize them, then we cannot know if concepts and intuitions have come together in a way that truly reflects how things are.

Maimon criticizes Kant because he holds that Kant still has not adequately shown that we are justified in believing in the applicability of a priori concepts that have their seat in the understanding to elements that arise a posteriori from the senses. Kant, according to Maimon, simply assumes that we are affected “from without” by things-in-themselves, and, in so doing, assumes the connection between a priori form and a posteriori content

Maimon’s solution is 1) to have a criterion of truth that comes from within cognition itself, and 2) to show how it is possible no longer to have the potentially unbridgeable gap between understanding and sensation. As concerns the first point, Maimon simply believes that he is being true to the spirit of critical philosophy insofar as he draws the criterion of truth from within consciousness. As concerns the second point, Maimon looks back to the rationalist school, and to Leibnizian philosophy in particular. If sensation ultimately has its root in the understanding, as it does for Leibniz, then there no longer is an issue of how two seemingly different elements of cognition can be combined together.

As his model, Maimon looks to mathematics insofar as the content of mathematics is not given to it empirically, or so holds Maimon. In differential calculus in particular, he finds a way in which content can be generated out of form. In short, Maimon thinks that all differences in quantity can be reduced to some sort of quantitative relation. Hence, in Maimon’s philosophy, differentials play the same role that things-in-themselves play for Kant. Differentials are not some type of a basic ontological entity such as atoms or monads. Instead, differentials are the rules concerning the lawful relationship of objects. Differentials give us the rule for producing an object. Take, for example, a triangle whose sides have the lengths 3 cm, 4 cm, and 5 cm, respectively. The relationship between the sides and the angles in that triangle will be the same as the relationship in a triangle whose sides have the lengths 3 rods, 4 rods, and 5 rods, respectively. The relationship between the sides and angles of these two triangles will be the same, too, as that in a triangle whose sides measure 9 inches, 12 inches, and 15 inches, respectively. The differential would be the rule for producing a triangle with the relations of sides and angles exhibited by any of the aforementioned triangles. Maimon holds that all the content of our knowledge would have to be able to be derived from a differential as are the lengths of the sides of the triangle mentioned above. Accordingly, all qualia, all the content of what we know, would be able to be understood in terms of differentials. Hence, for example, the redness of an apple would not be “given” from without; rather, it would be a rule for producing what which we experience empirically as the red color of the apple.

4. The Thing-In-Itself and the Infinite Understanding

In order to resolve the problem created by Kant’s doctrine of the thing-in-itself and in order to show just how the doctrine of differentials in Maimon’s philosophy can stand as a solution to the problem of the quid juris, it is necessary to understand Maimon’s notion of the infinite understanding.

As was hinted as earlier, Maimon does not have a criterion of truth that stands outside of consciousness. According to the commentator Hugo Bergmann, Maimon uses a doctrine that he finds in the Lebnizian philosopher Christian Wolff’s 1730 text entitled Ontologia. According to Bergmann, in that work, Wolff defines being as the completion of all possibility, that is, an object is fully actual when it is determined in all of its parts. Maimon uses this idea as the basis for his view of what the thing-in-itself must be. The object itself is no longer something outside of or beyond our cognition. The object is simply the sum of all predicates that can be attributed to it. In order to clarify this notion, Maimon employs a distinction between “presentation” (Darstellung) and “representation” (Vorstellung) that most likely comes from Mendelssohn. When the object is cognized as fully determined, it is known as it truly is, and is, thus, a “presentation.” When the object, however, is only partially cognized, it is not known in all of its determinations, and is, thus, a “representation.”

It is at this juncture that Maimon mentions the infinite mind. The object itself, as it actually is, that is, as presented, is the object insofar as it would be cognized by an infinite mind. The infinite mind does or would cognize objects in terms of differentials, that is, in terms of presentations. The infinite mind would not see objects as we humans see them, as given in space and time as well as insofar as they seem to be given from something outside of us. The infinite mind sees everything in terms of rational form, as quantified relations.

Several commentators mention the likely influence of Maimonides, as well as Spinoza, on Maimon’s doctrine of the infinite mind. In Book One, Chapter 68 of Maimonides Guide to the Perplexed, Maimonides – who, in turn looks back to Aristotle – calls God the intellectus, the ens intelligens, and the ens intelligible at one and the same time. God is the intellect, the thinking, and the thing that is being thought. In short, for Maimon, the thing-in-itself no longer is something that it outside of consciousness or in some other realm as that to which cognition must conform. Instead, the thing-in-itself would be the object as it would be cognized by an infinite mind, one that no longer needs to cognition as having two parts; matter, which is given to the understanding, and content, which is generated in and by the understanding. Maimon, in holding this view, sticks to the spirit of Kantian philosophy, as opposed to the letter insofar as he provides for a criterion of truth from within consciousness itself, one that need not refer to something beyond it, namely Kant’s infamous thing-in-itself.

There is some debate within Maimon scholarship as to whether the concept of the infinite mind is a “constitutive idea” or a “regulative idea” (in Kant’s sense of the terms). Cases can be made, especially when considering Maimon’s first book, the Versuch über die Transcendentalphilosophie on both sides of the issue. Some passages seem to point toward the infinite mind as something actual, whereas others point to it as a regulative idea, that is, a goal toward which we continually progress but that we can never fully attain. However, it seems that as Maimon’s view develops during the 1790’s that his view gravitates more toward the notion of the infinite mind as a regulative idea. That is, it is an ideal toward which we continually progress but which we can never fully attain.

5. Intuition

For Kant, there are elements of cognition that are not reducible to one another: concepts and intuitions. Because Maimon ultimately tries to reduce matter or content to something rational – namely differentials – the question arises as to what status intuition has in his philosophy. His position has many similarities to Leibniz’ view of senation. For Maimon, space and time, ultimately are concepts that deal pertaining to diversity.

Yet, in order to make sense of Maimon’s view of intuition, one must first understand his view on the role of the imagination (Einbildungskraft). Human beings, in Maimon’s view, possess finite faculties of cognition, unlike an infinite mind that would have an infinite faculty of cognition. The infinite mind would not see objects in terms of a matter or content that was given to it and which has been taken up, synthesized and, hence, given a form according to concepts generated by the understanding. Instead, the infinite understanding would cognize all objects in terms of concepts and differentials, that is, in a wholly rational or quantitative manner. Unfortunately, we humans do not cognize, say, the color red or the flavor of an apple or the sound of middle C played on the piano in terms of differentials. Aspects of these, their conceptual qualities, may be described according to categories or there may be rational aspects of the experience of them. Yet, according to Maimon, we still cognize the world in terms of form – which is rational and generated by us – and content – irrational and given to us from somewhere else or by something else.

Because we do not see the world as an infinite understanding would see the world, that is, as wholly rationally and quantitatively, we must have recourse to something else to aid the understanding. This role, for Maimon, belongs to the imagination . The imagination literally fills in where the understanding stops. Thus, for example, when we do not perceive the difference between two objects wholly in conceptual terms, the imagination fills in by generating intuitions. So, when we do not see two objects as conceptually different, their difference is manifested by the imagination in terms of temporal and spatial differences. Maimon has Leibniz’ notion of the identity of indiscernibles in mind here. (If two objects are identical, then the must be indiscernible). For Leibniz, if two objects are different, then there must be a conceptual basis for their difference. This conceptual difference plays out as a difference in intuition when the mind that cognizes this difference cannot understand it conceptually.

For Kant, space and time are a priori forms of intuition. Furthermore, Kant views them as pure forms of intuition. It is possible, on Kant’s view, to think of space and time devoid of all objects or prior to any objects that fill them out. Conversely, Maimon’s conception is much closer to that of Leibniz, where space and time as intuitions represent the relations between two or more objects. A space and time devoid of objects is impossible on his view. Furthermore, space and time as concepts, upon which the intuitions rest, are simply notions of diversity. For Maimon, the infinite mind does not or would not cognize objects either spatially or temporally; the infinite mind’s cognition would stand outside of all space and time.

6. Skepticism and the Quid Facti

Although Maimon formulates a possible solution to the quid juris, there remains, on his view, an important issue that must be addressed. Here, again, we return to the issue of the quid juris and its related problem of the quid facti. In the infamous “Transcendental Deduction” section of Kant’s first Critique, Kant attempts to show how it is possible for a priori concepts – ones that have their origin in the understanding – to be able to be united with intuition whose content arises empirically. On Maimon’s interpretation of Kant, Kant’s “solution” to the problem of the quid juris, which has recourse to the origin and nature of time, fails. According to this interpretation, one which is not unique to Maimon, because time is a priori and pure, as a form of intuition, and because time underlies all intuitions, be they spatial or temporal, time serves as the bridge between a priori concepts and intuitions, pure or a posteriori. It must be remembered that from the outset of the Critique of Pure Reason, Kant claims that he is attempting to prove how synthetic a priori statements are possible, not that synthetic a priori statements exist (he simply assumes this latter point). In other words, he is trying to show how it can be possible that experience of the world, and in particular scientific accounts of that experience, can have an a priori, and, thus, objective ground. Thus, simply put, by looking to mathematics he assumes that scientific experience, that is synthetic a priori statements, in fact, do exist. His task, in the first Critique, is to give an account of how it is possible for this experience to be objective or, which is the same, to show how there can be synthetic a priori statements.

Unfortunately, Maimon holds that the quid facti – that there exist synthetic a priori statements — remains unanswered and that this, in fact, is really a more serious problem. In other words, Maimon claims that it is not enough merely to show how it is possible that concepts of the understanding can come to be connected with so-called intuitions, that is, something seemingly given from without. Maimon holds that it still remains to be shown that concepts of the understanding actually are connected with intuitions. In short, Maimon questions Kant’s basic assumption that scientific experience exists, that is, that there actually are synthetic a priori statements. Hume, could be correct, in Maimon’s view. That is, we seem to see regularity in the world and the world seems to operate according to laws (of physics, biology, chemistry, etc.). However, this does not guarantee that the regularity that we think we see in the world or the conformity of events to laws actually has its basis in the laws themselves (or in the understanding). Hume could be correct that cause and effect are simply the mind’s habit of associating together objects or classes of objects and this would not make our experience of the world any different. In the end, the problem of the quid facti still remains. While it may be the case that there is regularity in our experience of the world, the does not guarantee as a fact that the understanding lies as the basis of this regularity, that is, that this regularity and law-like behavior is objectively valid.

Hence, the highest principles of philosophy and science are still, in Maimon’s strict view, hypotheses. Mathematics is the only discipline in which both the form and matter of the knowledge involved in the discipline can be shown to be created according to objectively valid laws by the understanding. Science and philosophy can and do give us systems that are internally coherent, but this does not guarantee that such systems actually map onto the world. The systems that science and philosophy have given us, perhaps, give good stories as to how the seemingly regularity of the world has arisen. However, this does not guarantee that the universe is regular and it also does not guarantee that any law (especially laws generated by the understanding) necessitate the world coming to pass as it does. Again, Hume could be correct and the order that we think that we see in the world could be the consequence of a habit of the mind.

As a result, scholars are divided on how to understand Maimon’s philosophy on the whole. Some critics claim that as his thought and writing unfolded in the 1790’s, the problem of the quid juris faded and the problem of the quid facti came more and more into the spotlight. Such critics tend to understand Maimon’s philosophy ultimately as a skepticism (Kuntze, Erdmann). One critic (Atlas) thinks that Maimon simply leaves us between the two horns of a dilemma, extreme rationalism and skepticism. Finally, some critics (Cassirer, Beiser) think that Maimon may have found a solution to the two horns of the dilemma or a so-called “middle path.” On this interpretation, Maimon admits that the quid facti is as of yet resolved. However, at least on Beiser’s interpretation, Maimon’s rationalistic model (with the theory of the infinite mind and differentials) as an ideal to which, step by step, we get closer. We can never reach this goal, as only an infinite intellect could do so. However, it is a goal toward which we should and do progress.

7. Transcendental Logic

As does Kant, Maimon holds that transcendental logic is in fact more basic than formal logic. The problem, on Maimon’s view, is that people traditionally hold logic to be a discipline that is independent from metaphysics. Maimon shows, however, that formal logic must, in fact, assume certain facts about reality, and, in particular, about objects. Hence, transcendental logic is prior to formal logic.

The standard view of formal logic is that it only deals with the form of judgments and abstracts from any content whatsoever. For example, the standard view is taken as holding that when one makes the claim that “If X implies Y and if Y implies Z, then X implies Z,” such a statement is true regardless of what is substituted in for “X,” “Y,” and “Z,” respectively. Furthermore, the standard view would be that the truth of this argument is solely a function of the form of the argument. According to Maimon, however, the problem with formal logic is by abstracting wholly from objects, it can only deal with one sort of diversity: negation. That is, in strict terms, if X is different from Y, then formal logic can only understand Y in terms of not-X. If “red” is symbolized by “X,” then formally, without any other assumptions, “blue” can only be symbolized as “not-X.” Similarly, “yellow” can only be symbolized as “not-X,” too. Be we know that yellow is not the same as blue.

Here is where, according to Maimon, transcendental logic underlies formal logic. Transcendental logic is a logic of content, whereas formal logic supposedly deals only with form. On Maimon’s view, in order for formal logic to be able to represent a diversity of objects – that is, in order that “blue” and “yellow” be not both symbolized by “not-X” and in order for them to be symbolized as, say, “Y,” and “Z,” respectively – then an actual diversity of objects must be assumed. This requires that the content of “X,” “Y,” and “Z” must be different, otherwise, the diversity of anything other than X could only be represented by “not-X.” Hence, Maimon claims that transcendental logic underlies formal logic and that formal logic must acknowledge that content does play a role for it.

8. The Principle of Determinability

Maimon shows himself to be a Kantian in spirit, as opposed to in letter, in the manner in which addresses the issue of logic and its relation to a system of philosophy and science. Maimon accepts Kant’s suggestion in the first Critique that a true science is one that could be derived from, and, hence, focused around one primary principle. In this respect, Maimon follows along the same lines as Reinhold and Reinhold’s “principle of consciousness,” for it is Reinhold in particular who claims that the Kantian philosophy needs to be systematized so that Kant’s claims can all ultimately be deduced from one main principle.

This principle, which Maimon labels the “principle of determinability” (Satz des Bestimmbarkeit), is related to his notion of transcendental logic, discussed above. What this principle, in theory, is supposed to achieve, is to provide a way for determining when thought is “really” true versus when it is only “formally” true. As an example, consider the statement: “all unicorns are one-horned.” Most would accept this statement as true on the basis that if one understands the concept “unicorn” and the concept “one-horned,” then one immediately sees that the statement must be true. The obvious problem is there are no unicorns. Hence, such a claim is only formally true and does not necessarily describe any feature of our world. If unicorns do indeed exist, then they must be one-horned. Yet, there are strong reasons for denying the existence of unicorns.

For Maimon, the principle of determinability holds that there is a determinable (Bestimmbare) that becomes determined by a determination (Bestimmung). The relationship between these two is one-sided. The determinable can be thought without the determination, whereas the determination can only apply to that particular determinable. Another way to view this is as the relationship between a subject and a true predicate. On Maimon’s account, the relation of determinability exists when this one-sided relationship holds. If the two can be thought apart from one-another, then the relationship of determinability does not exist and the judgment is not real; it is arbitrary. Thus, one cannot say with accuracy that “the table is sick.” Tables do not become sick and this is shown by the fact that “table” can be thought apart from “sick” just as much as “sick” can be thought apart from table. Accordingly, we do not speak – or think – correctly when we say that “the sick person is pale.” Both “sick person” and “pale” can be thought apart from each other and, hence, no relationship of determinability exists. To speak and to think properly, one needs to say that “the sick person’s color is pale.” Here, a relation of determinability exists because while one can think of “sick person” and never call to mind the concept of “paleness,” it is impossible to think of “paleness” without bringing in the concept of color. That is, “pale” is not a true determination of “sick person,” but rather “pale” is a determination of “color.” Likewise, “color” is a determination of “plane,” etc..

It must be remembered that Maimon holds that a subject or a determinable may only have one predicate or determination at any given time. As a result, true knowledge of an object would amount to a given chain of determinations going from the most particular determination up to the most general. In this respect, Maimon shows the influence of Leibniz on his philosophy because Maimon’s position amounts to the idea that the principle of sufficient reason now also becomes a standard or criterion for cognition. Every predicate or determination must be correctly lined to its proper subject or determinable and in doing so, one, literally, provides a sufficient reason as to why that particular determination and not some other must chosen. Thus, in a true science, we could move from the absolute particular or predicate all the way up to the most general statement or proposition. In such a fashion, the principle of determinability serves as a criterion for knowledge and in this respect Maimon again reflects the influence of rationalism on his thought.

9. Ethics and Legal Theory

The questions of the quid juris and the quid facti arise in Maimon’s writings on moral theory, too, and these are addressed in a series of journal articles and book chapters that appear between 1794 and 1800. In his article, “Versuch einer neuen Darstellung des Moralprinzips und Dedukzion seiner Realität” [“Attempt at a New Presentation of the Moral Principle and a Deduction of its Reality”] Maimon claims not to be offering a new moral principle from that of Kant, but rather a more cogent deduction of the moral principle. His main criticism of Kant’s deduction of the moral law in the Critique of Practical Reason concerns Kant’s use of the so-called “fact of reason” as a new starting point from which to begin moral philosophy. Although there are many different interpretations of what exactly this “fact of reason” is or entails, Maimon understands it to be the claim that all people feel themselves to be under moral constraint, which are the constraints of duty. Maimon agrees that people feel themselves to be under such moral constraint, but he denies that this moral constraint is necessarily the same thing as duty. In other words, he holds that although people may feel a compulsion [Zwang] to behave in a certain way, compulsion and duty [Pflicht] are, in fact, very different concepts.

So, Maimon sets out to provide a new foundation for duty. His strategy is to find something more basic than duty, yet out of which duty can be derived. He claims to have found this more basic “fact” in what he sees to be the drive in all humans for the cognition of truth. This “fact” is proven or guaranteed by the actual human condition (on Maimon’s view) that all humans strive after truth and Maimon assumes that this is undeniable. Furthermore, on his view, the essence of truth is universality or universal validity [Allgemeingültikeit]. On this conception, what makes something true is that fact that all rational beings, and especially an infinite being, could agree to the validity of the claim whose veracity is in question. In turn, the drive toward truth is based on an even more fundamental drive that all humans have: the so-called “drive toward making all representations universally valid” [Trieb zur Allgemeingültigmachung der Vorstellungen.].

Maimon, though, still needs to make an explicit connection between ethics and cognition. He achieves this insofar as he views reason as strictly instrumental in nature. In fact, reason and will are not separate faculties for Maimon. Reason can only tell us if action X is the best way to arrive at point B from point A, that is, if all people could, in theory, choose action X as the only means or the best means for arriving at Point B, as well as if arriving at point B as a goal is something that does not interfere with the goals of others. The good action, for Maimon, ends up being the universally valid action, the one to which all people, in theory, could assent.

Because willing now has a relation to truth, Maimon offers a slightly different formulation of that moral law than does Kant. His reformulated moral principle is: “Act so that your will can be thought of as the will of every rational being.” As it turns out, there are several differences of Maimon’s view from that of Kant. First, Kant’s Categorical Imperative focuses on the principle underlying willing – the maxim – whereas Maimon’s moral principle focuses on the act of willing itself. Second, Maimon literally means that an action would be wrong if every last rational being were not, at least in theory and when being rational, able to agree to it. For example, even if society as a whole wanted a convicted murderer to be put to death, it would be immoral to put the murdered to death, if this convicted murderer did not assent to such a punishment. Finally, Maimon holds that one cannot have duties toward oneself. That is, if one were the last remaining person on earth, then issues such as gluttony or suicide would no longer fall within the realm of morality because they would affect no other person but oneself.. For Maimon, morality becomes an issue only because of one’s relationship to other willing beings.

Parallel to the situation with his epistemology that was mentioned earlier, Maimon has, with this reformulation of the moral principle, given an answer to the question of the quid juris. That is, he has shown how it is possible to ground the moral law. In other words, he thinks that he has proven how the moral law possibly can affect us. However, the issue of the quid facti still remains because Maimon needs to show how, in fact, the moral law actually determines a person to behave in a certain manner. In this regard, Maimon goes in a different direction than Kant.

In his moral philosophy, Kant does not want to allow material principles to determine the will because he worries that any reliance on material principles amounts to a return to subjectivism. Material principles are simply principles arising from the content, as opposed to the form, of a person’s basis or reason for acting. To give an example, if one behaved in a certain manner because one desired happiness as one’s goal or because one wanted physical pleasure, then, on Kant’s view, material principles – happiness or pleasure – would be the determining ground of the will. Kant worries that all content turns out to be subjective and, thus, if any content becomes the “motive” for why a person acts, then that person acts on subjective grounds. In particular, Kant is worried about feelings (love, hate, envy) or abstract concepts (happiness, power) or states of mind (bliss, joy) as determininations of the will because all of these are “material,” and, hence, subjective. In other words, Kant holds that his version of the moral principle is universally valid specifically because its universality is derived from the form of the principle and not from the content of the situation in which one finds oneself. The only purely moral determining ground for the will, on Kant’s view, must be respect for the moral law. Anything else, such as love, compassion, etc, however, selfless it may seem to be, always ends up being subjective. Furthermore, Kant holds that we can only know after the fact that the moral law has determined one’s will and this is because it causes us pain or hurt, insofar as we did not behave in the manner in which we had originally desired to behave. Actually, he links “respect” for the moral law to the displeasure one feels in behaving against the way in which one wanted to behave.

Maimon finds Kant’s position unconvincing because he believes that the form of an action cannot ultimately serve as the motive for action. In short, on his view, the understanding or reason can never choose the ultimate goal for which we act. For Maimon, happiness or pleasure is, in the end, the reason for which we act. Fortunately, Maimon believes that there is one type of pleasure that is not subjective and which can serve as the basis for moral motivation. Loosely following Spinoza, Maimon believes that every increase in a being’s power is accompanied by a feeling of pleasure [Vergnügen]. True cognition, on his view, involves the ultimate increase in our power. Thus, every time a person performs a moral action, an action that is universally valid, the action is accompanied by a great pleasure. Hence, Maimon believes that the pleasure involved in moral action can serve as motivation to be moral and one that is not subjective at all.

As Maimon’s philosophy matures over his short writing career, he seems to move away from the view given above (somewhat paralleling what some commentators see happening in his epistemological views, too). By the time of the essay, the “Moral Skeptic” [Der moralische Skeptiker] of 1800, Maimon gives naturalistic account of ethics, seeing it basically in terms of legality, that is, as a way to protect peace and harmony between people in society. It seems as if in the domain of ethics that the issue of the quid facti still bothered Maimon and that he had to revise his account of why it is and how it is that people behave morally.

Related to, although different from his ethical theory, Maimon’s 1795 essay entitled, “Über die ersten Gründe des Naturrechts” [“On the First Grounds of Natural Law”] contains the clearest statement of Maimon’s legal theory. (Fichte goes out of his way to mention this essay in the introduction to his Foundations of Natural Right, published one year later). Maimon’s view is that legality and law aids in with the application and practice of morality. Often times, according to Maimon, there are situations in which no decision can be reached based solely on morality. It is in these cases that legality must be brought in to resolve the problem. For example, two people happen to come upon money on the sidewalk. A goodwill attempt to find the one who lost the money fails. Which of the two people can claim the money? In this case, morality cannot decide. Both people are morally justified in taking possession of the money as there is nothing immoral about one or the other pocketing the money. However, it is not possible for both to have the money. Law is supposed to aid such cases by setting down rules on how to resolves such situations.

10. Maimon’s Influence

Although Maimon’s career as a professional philosopher was short, his influence on what is now called “German Idealism” was significant. His acumen was recognized by important figures of the day such as Moses Mendelssohn, Kant, Kant’s student Marcus Herz, Reinhold, and Fichte. Fichte, in particular, recognized the importance of Maimon’s philosophy and he had written that his “respect for Maimon knows no bounds” and that later generations would look down on his own times for not giving Maimon his due. Maimon’s notion of logic and of intuition affected Fichte’s philosophy. Fichte’s attempt to secure the critical philosophy from skepticism was as much, if not more, of an answer to Maimon as it was to Aenesidemus-Schulze, a famous skeptic of the day. Fichte’s conception of the faculty of imagination is a development on Maimon’s view of this faculty. Maimon, as was shown above, revives rationalist doctrines found in Spinoza and Leibniz – the notion of an infinite mind, the idea of a complete concept, views about space and time, etc. – and many of these found their way back into Fichte’s own philosophy. In turn, subsequent idealist thinkers attempt to refine and ameliorate Fichte’s position. In many respects, the more important link in the development of German Idealism between Kant and Fichte was Maimon and not Reinhold or J. S. Beck, as the traditional view holds.

11. References and Further Reading

a. Original Editions of Maimon’s Book-Length Works (Chronological Order)

Versuch über die Transzendentalphilosophie , Berlin: Christian Voß and Sohn, 1790.
Gibeath Hamore, Berlin, 1791.
Philosophisches Wörterbuch, order Beleuchtung dre wichtigsten Gegenstände der Philosophie, in alphabetischer Ordnung, Berlin, Johann Friedrich Unger, 1791.
Salomon Maimons Lebensgeschichte, von ihm selbst geschriebenen herausgegeben von K.P. Moritz, Berlin, Friedrich Vieweg, 1792-93.
Bacons von Verulams neues Organon . Aus dem Lateinischen übersetzt von Geog Wilhelm Bartholdy. Mit Anmerkungen von Salomon Maimon, Berlin, Gottfried Carl Nauck, 1793.
Über die Progressen der Philosophie. Veranlaßt duch die Preisfrage der köngl. Akademie zu Berlin für das Jahr 1792: Was hat die Metaphysik seit Leibniz und Wolf für Progressen gemacht? Berlin, Wilhelm Vieweg, 1793.
Salomon Maimons Streiferein im Gebiet der Philosophie, Berlin, Wilhelm Vieweg, 1793.
Die Kategorien des Aristoteles, Berlin, Ernst Felisch, 1794.
Anfangsgründe der Newtonischen Philosophie von Dr. Pemberton, Berlin, Friedrich Mauer, 1793.
Versuch einer neuen Logik oder Theorie des Denkens. Nebst angeh?nten Briefen des Philateles annesidemus, Berlin, Ernst Felisch, 1794.
Kritische Untersuchungen über den menschlichen Geist oder das höhere Erkenntniß und Willensvermögen, Leipzig, Gerhard Fleischer, 1797.

b. Reprints and Translations of Maimon’s Writings (Books & Articles)

Gesammelte Werke, ed. Valerio Verra, Hildesheim, Olms Verlag, 1965-76. (7 volumes)
The Autobiography of Solomon Maimon, trans. J. Clark Murray, Champaign, University of Illinois Press, 2001.
Commentaires de Ma?monide, ed. Maurice-Ruben Hayoun, Paris, ?ditions du Cerf, 1999.
Essai sur la philosophie transcendantale, trans. Jean-Baptiste Scherrer, Paris, 1989.
“Letter of Philateles to Aenesidemus” trans. George di Giovanni, in Between Kant and Hegel: Texts in the Development of Post-Kantian Idealism, trans. and ed. George di Giovanni, Indianapolis, Hackett Publishing, 2001.
Versuch über die Transzendentalphilosophie, ed. Florian Ehrensperger, Hamburg, Germany: Felix Meiner Verlag, 2004.

c. Book-Length Studies of Maimon

Atlas, Samuel, From Critical to Speculative Idealism: The Philosophy of Solomon Maimon, The Hague, Martinus Nijhoff, 1964.
Bergmann, Samuel Hugo, The Philosophy of Solomon Maimon, trans. Noah H. Jacobs, Jerusalem, Magnes Press, 1967.
Bransen, Jan, The Antinomy of Thought: Maimonian Skepticism and the Relation between Thoughts and Objects, Dordrecht, Kluwer Publishing, 1991.
Buzaglo, Meir, Solomon Maimon: Monism, Skepticism and Mathematics, Pittsburgh, University of Pittsburgh Press, 2002.
Engstler, Achim, Untersuchungen zum Idealismus Salomon Maimons, Stuttgart-Bad Canstatt, Fromann Holzboog, 1990.
Salomon Maimon: Rational Dogmatist, Empirical Skeptic, ed. Gideon Freudenthal, Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2003
Gu?roult, Martial, La philosophie transcendantale de Salomon Maimon, Paris, Soci?t? d’?diton, 1930.
Kuntze, Friedrich, Die Philosophie Salomon Maimons, Heidelberg, Carl Winter, 1912.
Moiso, Francesco, La filosofia di Salomone Maimon, Milan, 1972.
Zac, Sylvain, Salomon Maimon – Critique de Kant, Paris, ?ditions du Cerf, 1988.

d. Journal Articles and Book Chapters in English on Maimon

Baumgardt, David, “The Ethics of Salomon Maimon,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 1, 1963, 199-210.
Beiser, Frederick, “Solomon Maimon, ” in The Fate of Reason – German Philosophy from Kant to Fichte, Cambridge, MA, Harvard University Press, 1987, 285-323.
Franks, Paul, “All or Nothing: Systematicity and Nihilism in Jacobi, Reinhold, and Maimon, ” in The Cambridge Companion to German Idealism, ed. Karl Ameriks, Cambridge, Cambridge University Press, 2000, 95-116.
Lachterman, David, “Mathematical Construction, Symbolic Cognition, and the Infinite Intellect: Reflections on Maimon and Maimonides, ” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 30 1992, 497-522.
Thielke, Peter, “Getting Maimon’s Goad: Discursivity, Skepticism, and Fichte’s Idealism ,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 39, 2001, 101-34.

Author Information

Andrew Kelley
Email: akelley@bradley.edu
Bradley University
U. S. A.

Aztec Philosophy

aztec Conquest-era Aztecs conceived philosophy in essentially pragmatic terms. The raison d’etre of philosophical inquiry was to provide humans with practicable answers to what Aztecs identified as the defining question of human existence: How can we maintain our balance while walking upon the slippery earth? Aztec philosophers addressed this question against an assumed metaphysics which held that the cosmos and its human inhabitants are constituted by and ultimately identical with a single, vivifying, eternally self-generating and self-regenerating sacred energy. Knowledge, truth, value, rightness, and beauty were defined in terms of the aim of humans maintaining their balance as well as the balance of the cosmos. Every moment and aspect of human life was meant to further the realization of this aim.

Introduction
Nahua Metaphysics
The Defining Problematic of Nahua Philosophy
1. How Can Humans Maintain their Balance on the Slippery Earth?
2. The Character of Wisdom
Epistemology
Intrinsic Value: Balance and Purity
Morality: Living in Balance and Purity
Aesthetics
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

a. Who were the Aztecs?

The indigenous peoples of Mesoamerica enjoy a long and rich tradition of philosophical speculation. The Aztecs and other Nahuatl-speaking peoples of the High Central Plateau of Mexico were no exception. Nahuatl-speaking peoples originated in northern Mexico and southwestern United States, migrating south in successive waves to the central Mexican highlands during the thirteenth and fourteenth centuries. Nahuatl is a member of the Uto-Aztecan linguistic family and related to Ute, Hopi, and Comanche. Nahuatl-speakers included among others the Mexicas (known to us but not to themselves as “Aztecs”), Texcocans, Chalcans, and Tlaxcaltecs. Due to their common language and culture, scholars standardly refer to Nahuatl-speakers as “Nahuas”, and to their culture, as “Nahua culture”. I follow this practice here. Nahua culture flourished in the fifteenth- and sixteenth- centuries prior to 1521 (CE), the fall of the Aztec capital, Tenochtitlan, and official date of the Conquest.

b. Sources for Studying Nahua Philosophy

Our sources for studying Conquest-era Nahua philosophy include: (1) native pictorial histories, ritual almanacs, tribute records, and maps, including the Codex Mendoza (painted several years after the Conquest), Codex Borgia (painted shortly before the Conquest), and Codex Borbonicus (painted about the time of the Conquest); (2) reports of the Spanish conquerors (e.g. Hernando Cortes and Bernal Diaz del Costillo); (3) ethnography-style works composed by missionaries (e.g. Friars Olmos, Motolinia, Sahagun, Duran and Mendieta) entering Mexico shortly after the Conquest — most notably Sahagun’s encyclopedic Historia General de las Cosas de Nueva Espana; (4) early seventeenth-century chronicles of Fernando de Alva Ixtlilxochitl and Domingo de San Anton Munon Chimalpahin Quauhtlehuanitzin, both Spanish-educated creole descendants of Aztec nobility; (5) native sources of non-Nahuatl-speaking indigenous peoples of Mexico (e.g. the Dresden Codex and Popol Vuh; (6) ethnographies of contemporary Nahuatl-speaking (e.g. Knab 1995; Sandstrom 1991) and non-Nahuatl-speaking (e.g. Hunt 1977; Monaghan 1995; Myerhoff 1974; Schaefer 2002; Tedlock 1992) indigenous peoples; and (6) archaeological studies (e.g. Smith 1996). (For further discussion see Carmack, et al. 1996; Leon-Portilla 1963).

c. The Approach of This Study

I approach Conquest-era Nahua philosophy by hermeneutical triangulation using the above sources. I assume Nahua philosophy to be a coherent body of thought consisting tentatively of four interrelated divisions: metaphysics, epistemology, theory of value, and aesthetics. In hermeneutical fashion, understanding Nahua philosophy as a whole depends upon understanding each division, while understanding each division depends upon understanding the other divisions as well as the whole.

Approaching Nahua philosophy in these terms is not without hazard. Although mainstays in European philosophy, they demarcate categories for which there are no precise, noncontroversial synonyms in Nahuatl. Nahua tlamatinime (“knowers of things,” “sages,” “philosophers;” tlamatini [singular]) do not appear to have analyzed philosophical thought in these terms. Rather, they conceived metaphysics, epistemology, theory of value, and aesthetics in conceptually overlapping if not equivalent terms.

Why then employ them? I believe doing so offers Western readers an intuitive first step into Nahua philosophy since they are deeply entrenched in Western thought. What’s more, they are commonly employed in Nahua scholarship (e.g. Burkhart 1989; Gingerich 1987, 1988; Leon-Portilla 1963; Lopez Austin 1988, 1997; Read 1998). Their heuristic utility notwithstanding, employing them must not mislead us into thinking that Nahua philosophers conceived philosophy in precisely these terms. Successfully understanding Nahua philosophy requires in the final analysis that we reconceive these divisions as a single, seamless conceptual whole. (For discussion of the pitfalls involved in using Western concepts to understand non-Western thought, see Asad 1986; Hall and Ames 1995; Maffie 2004; Wiredu 1996.)

I attribute the following views to the Nahuas generally, although it is more accurate to attribute them to the upper elite of priests, scholars, and educated nobility. Afterall, views differed between: priests, merchants, and farmers; men and women; dominant and subordinate city-states; and various regional and ethnic subgroups. I attribute the views to the period of the Mesoamerican-European contact, realizing full well that philosophies are living works in progress.

2. Metaphysics

a. Teotl as Ultimate Reality and Root Metaphor

At the heart of Nahua philosophy stands the thesis that there exists a single, dynamic, vivifying, eternally self-generating and self-regenerating sacred power, energy or force: what the Nahuas called teotl (see Boone 1994; Burkhart 1989; Klor de Alva 1979; Monaghan 2000; H.B. Nicholson 1971; Read 1998; Townsend 1972). Elizabeth Boone (1994:105) writes, “The real meaning of [teotl] is spirit — a concentration of power as a sacred and impersonal force”. According to Jorge Klor de Alva (1979:7), “Teotl …implies something more than the idea of the divine manifested in the form of a god or gods; instead it signifies the sacred in more general terms”. The multiplicity of gods in official, state sanctioned Aztec religion does not gainsay this claim, for this multiplicity was merely the sacred, merely teotl, “separated, as it were by the prism of human sight, into its many attributes” (I. Nicholson 1959:63f).

Teotl continually generates and regenerates as well as permeates, encompasses, and shapes the cosmos as part of its endless process of self-generation-and–regeneration. That which humans commonly understand as nature — e.g. heavens, earth, rain, humans, trees, rocks, animals, etc. — is generated by teotl, from teotl as one aspect, facet, or moment of its endless process of self-generation-and-regeneration. Yet teotl is more than the unified totality of things; teotl is identical with everything and everything is identical with teotl. Since identical with teotl, they cosmos and its contents ultimately transcend such dichotomies as personal vs. impersonal, animate vs. inanimate, etc. As the single, all-encompassing life force of the universe, teotl vivifies the cosmos and its contents. Lastly, teotl is both metaphysically immanent and transcendent. It is immanent in that it penetrates deeply into every detail of the universe and exists within the myriad of created things; it is transcendent in that it is not exhausted by any single, existing thing.

Nahua metaphysics is processive. Process, movement, becoming and transmutation are essential attributes of teotl. Teotl is properly understood as ever-flowing and ever-changing energy-in-motion — not as a discrete, static entity. Because doing so better reflects teotl’s dynamic and processual nature, I suggest (following Cooper’s [1997] proposal that we treat “God” of the mystical teachings of the Jewish Kabbalah as a verb) that we treat the word “teotl” as a verb denoting process and movement rather than as a noun denoting a discrete static entity. So construed, “teotl” refers to the eternal, universal process of teotlizing.

b. Dialectical Polar Monism

Although essentially processive and devoid of any permanent order, the ceaseless becoming of the cosmos is nevertheless characterized by an overarching balance, rhythm, and regularity: one provided by and constituted by teotl. Teotl’s and hence the cosmos’ ceaseless becoming is characterized by what I call “dialectical polar monism”. Dialectical polar monism holds that: (1) the cosmos and its contents are substantively and formally identical with teotl; and (2) teotl presents itself primarily as the ceaseless, cyclical oscillation of polar yet complementary opposites.

Teotl’s process presents itself in multiple aspects, preeminent among which is duality. This duality takes the form of the endless opposition of contrary yet mutually interdependent and mutually complementary polarities which divide, alternately dominate, and explain the diversity, movement, and momentary arrangement of the universe. These include: being and not-being, order and disorder, life and death, light and darkness, masculine and feminine, dry and wet, hot and cold, and active and passive. Life and death, for example, are mutually arising, interdependent, and complementary aspects of one and the same process. Life contains the seed of death; death, the fertile, energizing seed of life. The artists of Tlatilco and Oaxaca, for example, presented this duality artistically by fashioning a split-faced mask, one-half alive, one-half skull-like (see Markman and Markman 1989:90). The masks are intentionally ambiguous. Skulls simultaneously symbolize death and life, since life springs from the bones of the dead. Flesh simultaneously symbolizes life and death, since death arises from the flesh of the living. The faces are thus neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead all at once.

The Nahuas’ notion of duality contrasts with Zoroastrian-style eschatological dualisms. The latter claim: (1) order (goodness, life, light) and disorder (evil, death, darkness) are mutually exclusive forces; and (2) order (life, etc.) triumphs over disorder (death, etc.) at the end of history. Acording to Nahua duality, order and disorder, life and death, etc. alternate endlessly without resolution. It neither conceives death as inherently evil and life as inherently good nor advocates the conquest of death or the search for eternal life (see Caso 1958; Burkhart 1989; Carmack, et al. 1996; Hunt 1977; Knab 1995; Leon-Portilla 1963; Lopez Austin 1988, 1993, 1997; Monaghan 2000; Read 1998; Sandstrom 1991).

The created cosmos consists of the unending, cyclical tug-of-war or dialectical oscillation of these polarities — all of which are the manifold manifestations of teotl. Because of this, the created cosmos is characterized as unstable, transitory, and devoid of any lasting being, order or structure. Yet teotl is nevertheless characterized by enduring pattern or regularity. How is this so? Teotl is the dynamic, sacred energy shaping as well as constituting these endless oscillations; it is the immanent balance of the endless, dialectical alternation of the created universe’s interdependent polarities.

Because essentially processive and dynamic, teotl is properly characterized neither by being nor not-being but by becoming. Being and not-being are simply two dialectically interrelated presentations or facets of teotl, and as such inapplicable to teotl itself. Similarly, teotl is properly understood as neither ordered (law-governed) nor disordered (anarchic) but as unordered. Indeed, this point is fully general: life/death, active/passive, male/female, etc. are strictly speaking not predicable of teotl. Teotl captures a tertium quid transcending these dichotomies by being simultaneously neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead, simultaneously neither-orderly-nor-disorderly-yet-both-orderly-and-disorderly, etc.

In the end, teotl is essentially an unstructured and unordered, seamless totality. Differentiation, regularity, order, etc. are simultaneously fictions of human unknowing and artistic-shamanic presentations of teotl. In Western philosophical terminology, one perhaps best characterizes the radical ontological indeterminacy of Nahua metaphysics as an extreme nominalist anti-realism, and teotl, as a Kantian-like noumenon.

c. Pantheism

Nahuas philosophers also conceived teotl pantheistically: (a) everything that exists constitutes an all-inclusive and interrelated unity; (b) this unity is sacred; (c) everything that exists is substantively identical and hence one with the sacred; (d) the sacred is teotl. There is only one thing, teotl, and all other forms or aspects of reality and existence are identical with teotl; (e) teotl is not a minded being or ‘person’ (in the Western sense of having intentional states or the capacity to make decisions). (See Levine 1994 for discussion of pantheism.)

Hunt (1977) and I. Nicholson (1959) offer closely similar interpretations of pre-Hispanic metaphysics. Eva Hunt writes:

…reality, nature and experience were nothing but multiple manifestations of a single unity of being… The [sacred] was both the one and the many… It was also multiple, fluid, encompassing of the whole, its aspects were changing images, dynamic, never frozen, but constantly recreated, redefined (Hunt 1977:55f.).

Alan Sandstrom’s ethnography of contemporary Nahuatl-speakers in Veracruz, Mexico, offers a similar interpretation:

…everybody and everything is an aspect of a grand, single, overriding unity. Separate beings and objects do not exist–that is an illusion peculiar to human beings. In daily life we divide up our environment into discrete units so that we can talk about it and manipulate it for our benefit. But it is an error to assume that the diversity we create in our lives is the way reality is actually structured … everything is connected at a deeper level, part of the same basic substratum of being… The universe is a deified, seamless totality (Sandstrom 1991:138).

d. Teotl as Self-Transforming Shaman and Artist

Teotl’s ceaseless generating-and-regenerating of the cosmos is also one of ceaseless self-transformation-and-self-retransformation. The cosmos is teotl’s self-transformation or self-transmutation — not its creation ex nihilo. The Nahuas understood this process in two closely interrelated ways.

First, they conceived it artistically. Teotl is a sacred artist who endlessly fashions and refashions itself into and as the cosmos. The cosmos is teotl’s in xochitl, in cuicatl (“flower-and-song”). The Nahuas used “in xochitl, in cuicatl” to refer specifically to the composing and performing of song-poems and to refer generally to creative, artistic, and metaphorical activity (e.g. singing poetry, music, painting/writing [the Nahuas regarded painting and writing as a single activity]). As teotl’s “flower and song” the cosmos is teotl’s grand, ongoing artistic-cum-metaphorical self-presentation; teotl’s ongoing work of performance art or “metaphor in motion” (Markman and Markman 1989).

Second, they conceived teotl’s self-transmutation in shamanic terms. The cosmos is teotl’s nahual (“disguise” or “mask”). The Nahuatl word “nahual” derives from “nahualli” signifying a form-changing shaman (suggesting its indigenous shamanic roots). The continual becoming of the cosmos and its myriad aspects are teotl’s shamanic self-masking and self-disguising (see P. Furst 1976; Gingerich 1988; H.B. Nicholson 1971; Ortiz de Montellano 1990).

Teotl artistically-cum-shamanically presents and masks itself to humans in a variety of ways: (1) the apparent thingness of existents, i.e. the appearance of static entities such as humans, mountains, trees, insects, etc. This is illusory, since one and all are merely facets of teotl’s sacred motion; (2) the apparent multiplicity of existents, i.e. the appearance of discrete, independently existing entities such as individual humans, plants, mountains, etc. This is illusory since there is only one thing: teotl; and (3) the apparent exclusivity, independence, and irreconcilable oppositionality of dualities such as order and disorder, life and death, etc. This is illusory since they are interrelated, complementary facets of teotl.

As an epistemological consequence of teotl’s self-disguising, when humans customarily gaze upon the world, what they see is teotl as a human, as a tree, as female, etc.–i.e. teotl self-disguised — rather than teotl as teotl. As we shall see shortly below, wisdom enables humans to discern the sacred presence of teotl in its myriad disguises.

e. Teotl as Root Metaphor of Nahua Philosophy

Teotl functions as Stephen Pepper (1970) calls the “root metaphor” and what Alfredo Lopez Austin (1997) calls the “archetype” and “logical principle” governing the “unifying” “coherent nucleus” of Nahua philosophy. Teotl possesses metaphysical, epistemological, moral, and aesthetic facets in that it functions simultaneously as the source, object, and/or standard of reality, knowledge, value, rightness, and beauty.

f. Popular Aztec Religion

Many of the preceding claims were expressed mythologically and polytheistically in state-sanctioned, popular Aztec religion. Although the priests, nobility, and sages embraced its monistic aspect, the uneducated masses tended to embrace the polytheistic aspects of Nahua metaphysics (see Caso 1958; Leon-Portilla 1963:Ch II; H.B. Nicholson 1971:410-2; I. Nicholson 1959:60-3). State-sanctioned Aztec religion construed teotl as the supreme god, Ometeotl (literally, “Two God”, also called in Tonan, in Tota, Huehueteotl, “our Mother, our Father, the Old God”), as well as a host of lesser gods, stars, fire, and water (Leon-Portilla 1963). Ometeotl was the god of duality, a male-female unity who resided in Omeyocan, “The place of duality”, which occupied the highest levels of the heavens. S/he fathered/mothered her/himself as well as the universe. As “Lord and Lady of our flesh and sustenance”, Ometeotl provided the universal cosmic energy from which all things derived their original as well as continued existence and sustenance; s/he provided and maintained the oscillating rhythm of the universe; and s/he gave all things their particular natures. In virtue of these attributes s/he was called the “one through whom all live” (Caso 1958:8) and the one “who is the very being of all things, preserving them and sustaining them” (Alonso de Molina, in Leon-Portilla 1963:92). Because metaphysically immanent, Ometeotl was called Tloque Nahuaque, the “one who is near to everything and to whom everything is near” (Angel Garibay, quoted in Leon-Portilla 1963:93). Because epistemologically transcendent (in the sense that humans are not guaranteed knowledge of Ometeotl), Ometeotl was called Yohualli-ehecatl, the one who is “invisible (like the night) and intangible (like the wind)”.

g. Living in “The House of Paintings”

Nahua tlamatinime standardly characterized earthly existence as consisting of pictures, images, and symbols painted-written by teotl on its sacred amoxtli (Mesoamerican papyrus-like paper). The tlamatini Aquiauhtzin (ca.1430-ca.1500, from Chalco-Amaquemecan), for example, characterized the earth as “the house of paintings” (Cantares mexicanos fol.10 r., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1992:282.). According to Xayacamach (second half of the fifteenth century, from Tlaxcala), “Your home is here, in the midst of the paintings” (Cantares mexicanos fol.11 v., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1992:228). Like the images on amoxtli painted-written by human artists, the images on teotl’s sacred canvas are fragile and evanescent. The renowned tlamatini and ruler of Texcoco, Nezahualcoyotl (1402-1472), sung:

With flowers You paint, O Giver of Life!
With songs You give color, with songs you give life on the earth.
Later you will destroy eagles and tigers: we live only in your painting here, on the earth.
With black ink you will blot out all that was friendship, brotherhood, nobility.
You give shading to those who will live on the earth…
we live only in Your book of paintings, here on the earth. (Romances de los senores de Nueva Espana, fol.35 r., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1992:83).

Because they saw everything earthly as teotl’s nahual, Nahua tlamatinime claimed everything earthly is dreamlike. Tochihuitzin Coyolchiuhqui sung: “We only rise from sleep, we come only to dream, it is ahnelli [unrooted, untrue] it is ahnelli [unrooted, untrue] that we come on earth to live.” (Cantares mexicanos, fol.14v., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1992:153). Once again, Nezahualcoyotl sung:

Is it nelli [rooted, true, authentic] one really lives on the earth?
Not forever on earth, only a little while here.
Though it be jade it falls apart, though it be gold it wears away, though it be quetzal plumage it is torn asunder.
Not forever on this earth, only a little while here.
(Cantares mexicanos, fol 17r., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1992:80).

Nahua tlamatinime conceived the dreamlikeness or illusoriness of earthly existence in epistemological — not ontological — terms (pace Leon-Portilla 1963). Illusion was not an ontological category as it was, say, for Plato. In the Republic (Book VI) Plato employed the notion of illusion: to characterize an inferior or lower grade of reality or existence; to distinguish this inferior grade of reality from a superior, higher one (the Forms); and to deny that earthy existence is fully real. This conception of illusion commits one to an ontological dualism that divides the universe into two fundamentally different kinds of existents: illusion and reality.

Nahua tlamatinime employed the concepts of dreamlikeness and illusion as epistemological categories in order to make the epistemological claim that the natural condition of humans is to be deceived by teotl’s disguise and misunderstand teotl — not the metaphysical claim that as teotl’s disguise all earthly existence is ontologically substandard and not genuinely real. Earthly existence provides the occasion for human misperception, misjudgment, and misunderstanding. The dreamlike character of earthly existence, the mask of unknowing which beguiles us as human beings, is a function of our human perspective and teotl’s artistic self-disguise (these being ultimately one and the same!) — not a metaphysical dualism inherent in the make-up of things. When Nahua tlamatinime characterized earthly existence as ephemeral and evanescent, they did so not because earthly existence lacks complete reality but because as facets of teotl’s disguise they are subject to the endless oscillation of dialectical polar monism. Illusion is a function our mistaking the commonly perceived characteristics of the myriad shapes, structures, and entities of teotl’s disguise as characteristics of teotl itself. In sum, the Nahuas’ epistemological conception of illusion does not commit them to an ontological dualism between two different kinds of existents — illusion and reality — and is therefore consistent with their ontological monism.

A further consequence of Nahua monism is the metaphysical impossibility of human beings perceiving de re anything other than teotl, for teotl is the only thing to be perceived de re! But then how can Nahua tlamatinime claim that humans normally misperceive and misunderstand teotl? Humans normally perceive and conceive teotl de dicto or under a description, e.g. as Nezahualcoyotl, as maleness, as death, as night, etc. When doing so they perceive and conceive teotl’s nahual (self-disguise) and consequently perceive and conceive teotl in a manner that is ahnelli — i.e. untrue, unrooted, inauthentic, unconcealing, and nondisclosing. It is humans’ misperceiving and misunderstanding teotl as its disguise (nahual) which prevents them from seeing teotl (reality) as it really is.

The only way humans experience teotl knowingly is to experience teotl sans description. Humans experience teotl knowingly via a process of mystical-style union between their hearts and teotl that enables them to experience teotl directly i.e. without mediation by language, concepts, or categories. One comes to know teotl through teotl. One’s perception and conception are no longer befogged by “the cloud of unknowing” (to borrow from the fourteenth century English mystical text by the same name) or the “breath on the mirror” (to borrow from the Mayan Popol Vuh) constituted by de dicto perception and conception. Note however that although metaphysically immanent within human hearts (in keeping with Nahua metaphysical monism), teotl is nevertheless epistemologically transcendent in the sense that humans are not guaranteed knowledge of teotl.

A fundamental metaphysical difference thus divides the underlying problematics of Nahua and Cartesian-style Western epistemology. The latter conceives subject and object dualistically and the relationship between subject and object as one mediated by a “veil of perception”. The subject’s access to the object is indirect, being mediated, for example, by appearances or representations of the object. The Nahuas’ epistemological problematic conceives the subject and object monistically and the relationship between subject and object in terms of a mask. And masks in Mesoamerican epistemology have different properties than veils.

In their study of masks in Mesoamerican shamanism (in which sixteenth-century Nahua epistemology was deeply rooted and to which it remained closely related), Markman and Markman (1989:xx) argue that masks “simultaneously conceal and reveal the innermost spiritual force of life itself”. For example, the life/death masks mentioned above simultaneously conceal and reveal the simultaneously neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead figure. The mask does not symbolize, represent, or point to something deeper, something hiding behind itself, for the simultaneously neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead figure rests right upon the surface of the figure. The simultaneously neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead figure does not lurk behind the mask; nor is our access to it obstructed by a veil or representation. It is fully present de re yet hidden de dicto by our unknowing, i.e. by our normal tendency to misperceive reality as exclusively either dead or alive — as opposed to neither-alive-nor-dead-yet-both-alive-and-dead. After years of ritual preparation, Nahua tlamatinime were able to see the life-death mask de re or “unmasked” as it were, and in so doing discern the complementary unity and interdependence of life and death.

h. Time-space

Nahua metaphysics conceives time and its various patterns as the dynamic unfolding of teotl. Time and space form an indistinguisable time-space continuum. The four cardinal directions, for example, are simultaneously directions of space and time. Weeks, months, seasons, years, and year-clusters all had spatial directions. Time-space is concrete, quantitative, and qualitative. It does not consist of a uniform succession of qualitatively identical moments, nor is it a neutral frame of reference abstracted from terrestrial and celestial events and processes. The quantitative dimensions of time-space are inseparable from its qualitative, symbolic dimensions. Different time-spaces bear different qualities.

All these dimensions coalesced in the activity of Nahua time-space-keeping (astronomy), which included observing, counting, measuring, interpreting, giving an account of, and creating an artistic-written record of various patterns of time-space. Nahua time-space-keeping included tonalpohualli (“counting the days”) or counting the days of the 260-day cycle; xiuhpohualli (“counting the years”) or counting the days of the 360+5-day cycle; xiuhmolpilli (“binding the years”) or counting the 52 years of the “calendar round”; counting the 65 “years” of the cycle of Quetzalcoatl (the Venusian cycle); and counting other cycles in celestial and terrestrial processes. Nahua “time-keepers” (cahuipouhqui) were knowledgeable of the time-space rhythms of teotl and responsible for keeping society and humankind in balance with the cosmos.

Calendrical cycles govern human existence. A person’s birth date in the tonalpohualli determines her tonalli: a vital force having important consequences for her character and destiny. The Nahuas used the tonalpohualli to divine the nature of this force. The tonalpohualli assigned different daysigns to each day, each daysign having different effects on a person’s character and destiny. Time-space bears destinies, carried burdens, and conveyed these to events falling under its influence. The reckoning of any period of time-space always leads one to investigate the tonalli or “day-time-destiny” associated with it. Everything happening on the earth and in humans’ lives from birth to death is the outcome of tonalli.

The history of the universe falls into five successive ages or “suns,” each representing the temporary dominance of a different aspect of teotl. The present era, the “Age of the Fifth Sun,” is the final one and the one in which the Aztecs believed they lived. Like its four predecessors, the Fifth Sun is destined to cataclysmic destruction, at which time the earth will be destroyed by earthquakes and humankind will vanish forever. (For further discussion, see Lopez Austin 1988, 1997; Leon-Portilla 1963; Read 1998; Carrasco 1990; Maffie [forthcoming].)

3. The Defining Problematic of Nahua Philosophy

a. How Can Humans Maintain their Balance on the Slippery Earth?

The Nahua regarded earthly life as filled with pain, sorrow, and suffering. Indeed, the earth’s surface is a treacherous habitat for human beings. Its name, “tlalticpac,” literally means “on the point or summit of the earth”, suggesting a narrow, jagged, point-like place surrounded by constant dangers (Michael Launey, quoted in Burkhart 1989:58). The Nahuatl proverb, “Tlaalahui, tlapetzcahui in tlalticpac,” “It is slippery, it is slick on the earth,” was said of a person who had lived a morally upright life but then lost her balance and fell into moral wrongdoing, as if slipping in slick mud (Sahagun 1953-82:VI,p.228, trans. by Burkhart 1989). Humans lose their balance easily on tlalticpac and so suffer misfortune frequently. They therefore desparately need guidance.

Nahua tlamatinime conceived the raison d’etre of philosophy in terms of this situation, and turned to philosophy for practicable answers to what they regarded as the defining question of human existence: How can humans maintain their balance upon the slippery earth? This situation and question jointly constitute the problematic which functions as the defining framework for Nahua philosophy. Morally, epistemologically, and aesthetically appropriate human activity are defined in terms of the goal of humans maintaining their balance upon the slippery earth. All human activities are to be directed towards this aim. At bottom, Nahua philosophy is essentially pragmatic.

Because of this I suggest Nahua philosophy is better understood as a “way-seeking” rather than as a “truth-seeking” philosophy. “Way-seeking” philosophies such as classical Taoism, classical Confucianism, and contemporary North American pragmatism adopt as their defining question, “What is the way?” or “What is the path?”. In contrast, “truth-seeking” philosophies such as most European philosophies adopt as their defining question, “What is the truth?” (For discussion see Hall 2001; Hall and Ames 1998; Maffie [ed] 2001.)

To the question, “How can humans maintain their balance upon the slippery earth?”, Nahua tlamatinime answered, “Humans must conduct every aspect of their lives wisely”. To the question, “What is the best path for humans to follow on the narrow, jagged surface of the earth?”, they answered, “The balanced, middle path since it avoids excess and imbalance, hence mistepping and slipping, hence misfortune and ill-being”.

b. The Character of Wisdom

Wisdom aims at instructing humans how to maintain their balance (like skilled mountaineers) as they walk upon the narrow, twisting, and jagged path of life upon the summit of the earth (see Burkhart 1989; Gingerich 1988; Leon-Portilla 1963; I. Nicholson 1959). The Nahuas conceived wisdom dynamically in terms of balancing — a conception rooted in indigenous shamanism (see Eliade 1964; Gingerich 1988; P. Furst 1976; Myeroff 1974) and in their conception of teotl. They conceived wisdom adverbially, not substantively. Wisdom is a characteristic of how one conducts oneself and one’s affairs — not a thing or a set of eternal truths one grasps, apprehends, or possesses. By enabling them to walk in balance, wisdom affords humans some measure of stability and well-being in an otherwise evanescent life filled with pain, sorrow, struggle, and suffering, here on an impermanent, doomed earth.

Nahua sages conceived tlamatiliztli (knowledge, wisdom) in pragmatic, creative, and performative terms rather than in propositional or theoretical terms. Tlamatiliztli consists of non-propositional ‘know how’ — not propositional ‘knowledge that’. It consists of knowing how to live so as to make one’s way safely upon the slippery surface of earth. How do humans become wise? They must become neltiliztli, i.e. well-rooted, authentic, true, and non-referentially disclosing. Their intellectual, emotional, imaginative, and physical dispositions and behavior must become deeply and firmly rooted in teotl.

Tlamatiliztli involved four, ultimately indistinguishable aspects: (1) the practical ability to conduct one’s affairs in such a way as to attain some measure of balance and purity–and hence some measure of well-being–in one’s personal, domestic, social, and natural surroundings; (2) the practical ability to conduct one’s life in such a way as to creatively participate in, reinforce, adapt, and extend into the future the way of life inherited from one’s predecessors; (3) the practical ability to conduct one’s life in such a way as to participate in the regeneration-cum-renewal of the cosmos, and; (4) the practical know how involved in performing ritual activities which: genuinely present teotl; authentically embody teotl; preserve existing balance and purity; create new balance and purity; and participate alongside teotl in the regeneration of the universe.

The Nahua universe is a “participatory universe” characterized by a “relationship of compelling mutuality” or “interdependence” between humans and universe (Wilbert 1975; see also Leon-Portilla 1993; Lopez Austin 1988, 1997; Read 1998; and Sandstrom 1991). This is simply a consequence of the interrelatedness and oneness of all things. Not only does the universe causally affect humans, but humans causally affect the universe. Human actions promote cosmic harmony, balance, and purity, on the one hand, or cosmic disharmony, imbalance, and impurity, on the other.

The Nahuas conceived moral, psychological, and physical (these all being indistinguishable in their eyes) health, well-being, righteousness, and purity in terms of keeping one’s balance on the earth’s slippery surface, and so regarded the earth’s surface as a psychologically, physically, and morally dangerous place. Nahua wisdom urged humans to act with extreme care and to follow the guidelines of the ancestors — as any other path would inevitably lead one to stumble down the earth’s slopes into psychological, physical, and moral imbalance, perverseness, instability, and disease. With this in mind, a father offered his son the following advice:

… on earth we travel, we live along a mountain peak. Over here there is an abyss, over there there is an abyss. Wherever thou art to deviate, wherever thou art to go astray, there will thou fall, there wilt thou plunge into the deep (Sahagun 1953-82:VI,p.125).

Yet the dire situation of humans on earth did not prompt the Nahuas to reject earthly life in favor of some other-worldly life. The earth’s surface is the only realm wherein humans enjoy the full potential for well-being since only here are their various vital forces fully integrated. The Nahuas resolved to live as best they could on tlalticpac. And indeed, earthly life does allow some measure of well-being: sleep, laughter, food, sexual pleasure, conjugal union, and procreation. Yet these were scarce, momentary, and needed to be taken in moderation, as any excess resulted in imbalance. This ambiguous character of earthly life is summarized in a mother’s advice to her daughter: “the earth is not a good place. It is not a place of joy; it is not a place of contentment. It is merely said it is a place of joy with fatigue, of joy with pain” (Sahagun 1953-82:VI,p.93).

Nahua philosophers saw humans as creatures yearning for rootedness — i.e. for a deep, firm, and lasting anchoring for their lives — and who restlessly search for it. Obtaining well-rootedness enables one to become an “upright man” (tlacamelahuac, trans. by Lopez Austin 1988:I,p.189) and to live a balanced, pure, and genuinely human life. Without roots, one finds neither balance, purity, nor humanness. Obtaining well-rootedness is difficult, and in their search many humans give their hearts to what appears to be well-rooted and authenthic but is not. Since this cannot provide grounding and stability, humans eventually become dissatisfied with it and abandon it, only to begin their search anew, often times repeating the process over and over again. Their hearts eventually become scattered, unbalanced, and lost (Lopez Austin 1988:II, Appendix 5). As Nezahualcoyotl put it, “If you give your heart to each and everything, you lead it nowhere: you destroy your heart” (Cantares mexicanos fol.2, v., trans. by Leon-Portilla 1963:5). Such humans become vagabonds, wandering about aimlessly from one illusion to the next. They become beastly, unstable, unbalanced, impure, perverse, dull-witted, intemperate, and vicious. They fail to realize their humanness and merely appear to be human. They become deceivers, rogues, and dissimulators. They “act on things with [their] humanity dead” (Lopez Austin 1988:I,p.189). They are “lump[s] of flesh with two eyes” (Sahagun 1953-82:X,pp.3,11) and “defective human weight[s]” (Sahagun 1953-82:X,p.11, trans. by Lopez Austin 1988:II,p.271).

The beastly apparent-human eschews the company of other humans and in so doing forsakes his humanness in yet another way. Humans are essentially social; they need the company of others in order to become genuine human beings. Humans are born “faceless” (i.e. incomplete or with undeveloped powers of judgment) and need other humans for the education and discipline needed for acquiring a “face”, becoming balanced, and becoming fully human. Developing proper “face and heart” is only possible through the opportunities provided by well-ordered social living. Unstable, foolish, and diseased, the loner slips constantly upon the path of life.

The notion of maintaining one’s balance plays a central role in other aspects of Nahua thought. One’s mind and body possess or lack balance, and are healthy or not depending upon whether they possess the proper balance of opposing polarities such as hot and cold, dry and wet, etc. (Lopez Austin 1988:I,ch.8). One’s home, neighborhood, polity, and environment are healthy or diseased depending upon whether they are balanced or not. Personal, domestic, and social balancedness are interdependent. Imbalance, iimpurity, and ill-being are contagious.

The Nahuas believed the human body serves as the temporary location for three different animistic forces, each residing in its own center. Tonalli (from the root tona, “heat”) resides in the head. It provides the body with character, vigor, and the energy needed for growth and development. Individuals acquire their tonalli from the sun. A person’s tonalli may leave her body during dreams and shamanic journeys. Tonalli is ritually introduced into an infant as one of her animistic entities. It is closely united to a person as her link to the universe and as determining factor of her destiny. Everything belonging to a human by virtue of her relation to the cosmos received the name of tonalli. Teyolia (“that which gives life to people”) resides in the heart. It provides memory, vitality, inclination, emotion, knowledge, and wisdom. Unlike tonalli, one’s teyolia is not separable while alive. It “goes beyond after death” and enjoys a postmortem existence in the world of the dead. The Nahuas likened teyolia to “divine fire” (Carrasco 1990:69). Finally, ihiyotl (“breath, respiration”) resides in the liver. It provides passion, cupidity, bravery, hatred, love, and happiness.

Every human is the living center and confluence of these three forces. They direct humans’ physiological and psychological processes, giving each person her own unique character. All three must operate harmoniously with one another in order to produce a mentally, physically, and morally pure, upright, whole, and balanced person. Disturbance of any one affects the other two. Only during life on earth are all three forces fully integrated within humans. After death, each goes its own way.

Lastly, individuals possess free will within the constraints imposed by their tonalli. One is born with either favorable or unfavorable tonalli and with a corresponding predetermined character. While this places certain constraints upon what one may accomplish, one freely chooses what to make of one’s tonalli within these limits. Someone born with favorable tonalli may squander it through improper action; someone with unfavorable tonalli may neutralize its adverse effects through knowledge of the sacred calendar and careful selection of actions. (For further discussion, see Lopez Austin 1988, 1997; J. Furst 1995; Carrasco 1990; Sandstrom 1991.)

4. Epistemology

a. The Raison D’etre of Epistemology

The philosophical problematic above defines the raison d’etre of Nahua epistemology. The aim of cognition from the epistemological point of view is walking in balance upon the slippery earth, and epistemologically appropriate inquiry is that which promotes this aim. Nahua epistemology does not pursue goals such as truth for truth’s sake, correct description, and accurate representation; nor is it motivated by the question “What is the (semantic) truth about reality?” Knowing (tlamatiliztli) is performative, creative, and participatory, not discursive, passive or theoretical. It is concrete, not abstract; a knowing how, not a knowing that.

b. Truth as Well-Rootedness-cum-Alethia

Nahua epistemology conceived knowing (tlamatiliztli) in terms of neltiliztli. Scholars standardly translate neltiliztli (and its cognates) as “truth” (and its cognates) (Karttunen 1983; Gingerich 1987; Leon-Portilla 1963). However, unlike most Western philosophers, Nahua philosophers did not understand truth in terms of correspondence (or coherence). According to Leon-Portilla (1963:8), “`truth’… was to be identified with well-grounded stability [well-foundedness or well-rootedness].” To say a person cognizes truly is therefore to say she cognizes with well-grounded stability or well-rootedly. Nahua philosophers thus possessed a concept of truth (neltiliztli) but they conceived truth in terms of well-grounded stability, well-foundedness, and well-rootedness — not in terms of correspondence, aboutness, representation, reference, fit, or successful description. In short, they understood neltiliztli (truth) non-semantically.

Willard Gingerich (1987:102f.) defends Leon-Portilla’s translation-interpretation of neltiliztli. He points out that “truth” occurs in the early post-Conquest sources more often in its adverbial form, nelli, meaning “truly” or “with truth” (which I believe reflects the Nahuas’ processive metaphysics). However, Gingerich contends well-rootedness does not exhaust the full meaning of neltiliztli. The Nahuas’ understanding of neltiliztli contained an ineliminable Heideggerian component: “non-referential alethia — [i.e.] ‘disclosure,'” (1987:104), “unconcealedness” (1987:102), “self-deconcealing” (1987:105), and “unhiddenness” (1987:105). That which is neltiliztli is both well-rooted and non-referentially unconcealing or disclosing. Nahuas understood neltiliztli (truth) non-semantically, i.e. in terms other than correspondence, reference, representation, and aboutness. In sum, Nahua epistemology conceives neltiliztli in terms of well-rootedness-cum-alethia.

The Nahuas characterized persons, things, activities, and utterances equally and without equivocation in terms of neltiliztli, and understood neltiliztli in terms of well-rootedness in teotl. That which is well-rooted in teotl is genuine, true, authentic, and well-balanced as well as non-referentially disclosing and unconcealing of teotl (Gingerich 1987, 1988; Maffie 2002). Created things exist along a continuum ranging from those that are well-rooted in teotl (i.e. nelli) and hence authentically present and embody teotl as well as disclose and unconceal teotl, at one end, to those things that are poorly rooted in teotl (i.e. ahnelli) and hence neither authentically embody and present teotl nor disclose and unconceal teotl, at the other end. The former, which include fine jade and well-crafted song-poems (“flower and song”), enjoy sacred presence.

c. Cognitive Burgeoning and Flowering

Humans thus cognize knowingly if and only if they cognize with well-rootedness-cum-alethia. They cognize with well-rootedness-cum-alethia if and only if their cognizing is well-rooted in teotl. The Nahuas conceived well-rootedness-cum-alethia in terms of burgeoning (Brotherston 1979). Burgeoning and rootedness are both vegetal notions deriving from the organic world of agricultural life. A plant’s flowers and fruits burgeon from its seeds, soil, and roots, and in so doing embody, present, and disclose the latter’s qualities. Analogously, cognizing knowingly is a form of cognitive flourishing. It is the flower of an organic-like process consisting of teotl’s sap-like burgeoning, unfolding, and blossoming within a person’s heart. By doing so, teotl discloses and unconceals itself. As the generative presentation of teotl, human knowing thus represents one of the ways teotl faithfully, genuinely, and authentically discloses itself here on earth. As a consequence, human cognizing moves knowingly: it understands, presents, embodies, enacts, and expresses teotl.

By contrast, unknowing (illusory, befogged) cognizing is poorly if not wholly unrooted (ahnelli) in teotl. It is inauthentic, ingenuine, and undisclosing. Teotl fails to burgeon, flower, and faithfully disclose itself within such cognizing. Unknowing cognition constitutes a form of cognitive crookedness, perversity, or disease. It represents one of the ways by which teotl unfaithfully and inauthetically presents — i.e. disguises and masks — itself here on earth.

Humans come to know teotl using their heart — not head or brain. Situated between head and liver, the heart is uniquely qualified to attain the proper balance of the head’s reason and the liver’s passion needed for understanding teotl. The heart serves as the center for teyolia, that vital force which induces humans towards that which alone fills their emptiness and gives them roots: teotl. Knowing requires that one possess a yolteotl or “teotlized heart”, i.e. a heart charged with teotl’s sacred energy and enjoying sacred presence. The “teotlized heart” possesses an extraordinary amount of teyolia. One possessing a “teotlized heart” has “teotl in his heart” and is “wise in the things of teotl” (Lopez Austin 1988:I,pp.258ff., II,pp.245,298; see also Leon-Portilla 1963).

Yollotl, the Nahuatl word for heart, derives from ollin, the Nahuatl word for movement (Lopez Austin 1988). This indicates yet another way in which the heart the organ best suited for knowing teotl way. Teotl is essentially movement. A teotlized heart moves in balance with the movement of teotl, and as a result moves knowingly. As one’s heart comes to move knowingly, one becomes “wise in the things of teotl”; one comes to have “teotl in his heart”. Teotl presents and discloses itself to and through one’s heart. One experiences teotl directly and de re. The de dicto mask of unknowing beguiles one’s heart no more.

Teotl is ultimately ineffable since it is undifferentiated and unordered; a seamless totality. Consequently, humans only experience teotl knowingly in a manner unmediated, unspecified, and undefined by language, concepts, and categories (along with their divisions, classification, and distinctions). These are facets of teotl’s disguise or mask and thus contribute to humans’ de dicto misperceiving and misunderstanding of teotl. To the degree language, concepts, and categories are essential to human reasoning, humans thus understand teotl non-rationally. Alternatively expressed, teotl only genuinely discloses itself non-linguistically, non-discursively, and non-rationally.

d. “Flower and Song”

In light of the preceding, Nahua tlamatinime turned to “flower and song” (poetry, writing-painting, music) to disclose and present (not re-present) teotl as well as display and embody their understanding of teotl. Composing-and-performing song-poems in particular are the highest form of human artistry and the finest way for humans to present teotl since this activity most closely imitates and participates in teotl’s own cosmic, creative artistry. Hence song-poems rather than discursive arguments are the appropriate medium of sagely expression, and sages are perforce singer-songwriter-poets.

“Flower and song” comes from a ritually prepared heart that embodies and presents a proper balance of reason and passion, male and female, active and passive, etc. This balance was symbolized in popular Aztec religion by Quetzalcoatl, the “Plummed Serpent”, who served as patron deity of artists and sages. By combining the attributes of birds (heaven) and snakes (earth), the “Plummed Serpent” symbolized the union of male and female. Indeed, Quetzalcoatl’s joint patronage of sages and artists points to their ultimate identity and to the equivalence of sagacity and artistic excellence.

Acquiring a teotlized heart and becoming knowledgeable of teotl also requires that one engage in “flower and song”. Artistic activity epistemologically improves one’s heart, causing it move in balance with teotl and hence move knowingly. By engaging in creative artistry humans imitate and participate in — albeit imperfectly — the self-transforming, cosmic creativity of teotl. In so doing they fashion their hearts after teotl.

Acquiring a teotlized heart and becoming knowledgeable of teotl also requires that one be well-rooted, well-balanced, pure, authentic, and morally righteous, and that one possess strength, self-control, moderation, and modesty (see Gingerich 1988; Burkhart 1989). Humans must show humility and respect towards teotl before teotl discloses itself. The foregoing characteristics are not only epistemological but moral and aesthetic as well. They not only help humans become knowledgeable and live wisely, they help them live morally, authentically, purely, well-balancedly. and beautifully. Humans cannot become knowledgeable of teotl without becoming genuine, pure, morally righteous and beautiful (and vice versa). In short, the process of epistemological self-improvement is also one of moral and aesthetic self-improvement.

Finally, the Nahuas understood the process of becoming knowledgeable in terms of tlamacehualiztli or “the meriting of things”. According to Burkhart (1989:142), tlamacehualiztli derives from the verb macehua, “to obtain or deserve what is desired” (see also Klor de Alva, 1993; Leon-Portilla 1993; Gingerich 1988; Read 1998). Humans come to “merit” — i.e. “deserve” or “be worthy of” — tlamatiliztli as a consequence of performing prescribed ritual activities. Humans and teotl coexist in a moral interrelationship of reciprocity, and becoming knowledgeable involves a morally regulated exchange with teotl. When humans behave in ritually prescribed ways, they may expect to attain those things they have come to merit. Tlamatiliztli emerges as a consequence of moral-cum-epistemological-cum-aesthetic interaction and co-participation with teotl.

5. Intrinsic Value: Balance and Purity

Nahua value theory sees balance and purity jointly as the condition that is ideal as well as intrinsically valuable and worth-cultivating for humans. To the degree humans approximate balance-and-purity in their lives, they perfect their humanness and flourish; to the degree they do not, they destroy their humanness and suffer beastly, miserable lives. Nahua theory of intrinsic value is rooted in Nahua metaphysics in the following way. Teotl functions as the ultimate source and standard of intrinsic value since balance-and-purity are properties of teotl. Teotl’s own balance-and-purity are genuinely embodied and presented in well-formed quetzal tail feathers, jade, and turquoise. Thet are green: the color of balance, purity, life, renewal, and well-being (Sahagun 1953-82:XI, pp.224,248; see also Gingerich 1988; Burkhart 1989.) One obtains this balance-and-purity by rooting oneself firmly and deeply in teotl.

6. Moral Theory: How to Live in Balance and Purity

Nahua philosophy reflects upon the appropriateness of human conduct, attitudes, and states of affairs from the standpoint of achieving, restoring, and maintaining balance-and-purity. This single point of view encompasses under a single rubric what Western thought standardly divides into moral, religious, political, legal points of view. Nahua philosophers saw no significant difference between these, however. For simplicity’s sake I discuss this single point of view using the terms “morality”, “ethics” and their cognates.

Nahua morality is rooted in the claim that balance-and-purity constitute the ideal condition as well as what is intrinsically valuable for humans, and derives two fundamental moral precepts from this claim: humans should promote balance-and-purity and avert imbalance-and-impurity. Nahua morality accordingly appraised the moral appropriateness of conduct, attitudes, and states of affairs in light of their consequences upon balance-and-purity. Morally appropriate conduct, for example, is that which promotes, sustains or renews balance-and-purity or that which averts imbalance-and-impurity; morally inappropriate conduct is that which disrupts existing balance-and-purity or creates new imbalance-and-impurity (see Burkhart 1988; Gingerich 1988; Lopez Austin 1988, 1997). Good intentions do not suffice; one must actually succeed.

Nahua ethics standardly characterizes morally appropriate conduct as in quallotl in yecyotl, i.e. as that which is “fitting for” and “assimilable by” humans in the sense of contributing to their balance-and-purity. Morally appropriate conduct helps humans “assume a face,” “develop a heart,” and enrich their life. It helps them become authentically human. Morally inappropriate conduct, on the other hand, causes humans to leave their heart undeveloped, lose their face, and impoverish their lives. It causes them to become lumps of flesh with two eyes. (See Leon-Portilla 1963:146-48; Burkhart 1989:38ff.; Gingerich 1988:524; Lopez Austin 1988, 1997.)

The soundest, wisest course is moderation. One should neither do too much nor too little of anything: e.g. eating, sleeping, or bathing. If one overindulges by feasting, one must restore balance by overindulging in its contrary, fasting. Acting wisely consists of walking a middle path between two extremes. As a Nahuatl proverb proclaims: tlacoqualli in monequi: “the center good is required,” “the middle good is necessary” (Sahagun 1953-82:VI, p.231, trans. by Burkhart 1989:134).

Nahua ethics also employs the notion of tlatlacolli — i.e. damage, harm or spoilage — when characterizing the moral character of conduct (Burkhart 1989:28). Immoral conduct is tlatlacolli because it causes an entity to suffer a loss of balance, which in turn causes it to suffer decay, disorder, randomness, and spoilage. Spoilage in humans, for example, typically results in physical or psychological disease. Nahua ethics also uses the notions of purity and impurity in this regard. The basic Nahuatl pollution concept is tlazolli, the most literal meaning of which is, “something useless, used up, something that has lost its original order or structure and has been rendered loose and undifferential matter” (Burkhart 1989:88). Immorality is identified with dirt and filth. Immoral behavior is dirty because it pollutes the actor(s) involved, e.g. two adulterers. Purity and impurity are closely related to spoilage. Moral impurity is a form of spoilage accompanied by a loss of balance.

Nahua ethics had a this-worldly rather than other-worldly orientation. Its foundation and justification rested in human nature, the nature of life on earth, and ultimately the nature of the teotl — not in the commandments of some remote deity. The Nahuas’ search for the correct codes of conduct was not motivated by a desire for reward in an afterlife, nor did it presuppose the possibility of determining one’s destiny after death. There was no talk of punishment or reward in an afterlife for the kind of life one led on earth.

This notwithstanding, Nahua morality did prescribe a way of life which promised well-being here on earth. The Nahuas believed the destiny of humankind in the beyond to exceed human control and knowledge, and concluded that the rewards and punishments for earthly conduct are earthly. These included conversation, health, laughter, sleep, strength, sexual pleasure, honor, longevity and respect in the case of morally appropriate behavior; hunger, pain, sorrow, insanity, physical deformity and disease in the case of inappropriate behavior.

The Nahuas characterized education as “the art of strengthening or bringing up men” (tlacahuapahualiztli) and “the act of giving wisdom to the face” (neixtlamachiliztli). Humans are born incomplete and “faceless” (i.e. without character) yet are perfectible through proper education (Leon-Portilla 1963; Lopez Austin 1988). Education aims at perfecting children by developing in them “a wise face and a strong, humanized heart” and fashioning their character into a “well smoked, precious turquoise” (Sahagun 1953-82:VI,p.113). This equips them with the means for keeping their balance on the slippery earth. Towards this end Nahua education sought to cultivate dispositions that enable humans to live well (such as self-control, self-sufficiency, moderation, modesty, and personal and domestic hygiene) and extricate dispositions that disable humans (such as pride, intemperance, carelessness, duplicity, uncleanliness, gluttony, and drunkenness).

Only tlamatinime were qualified to cultivate wisdom in people. In his/her capacity as educator, moralist, and role model — i.e. as “teacher of people’s faces” (teixtlamachtiani) — the sage is akin to an artist who skillfully shapes a formless block of stone into a beautiful statue. The sage shapes a child’s “faceless”, lump of human flesh into a genuinely human “face and heart”. Of the sage the Nahuas said:

The wise man: a light, a torch, a stout torch that does not smoke.
A perforated mirror, a mirror pierced on both sides.
His are the black and red ink, his are the illuminated manuscripts, he studies the illuminated manuscripts.
He himself is writing and wisdom.
He is the path, the true way for others.
He directs people and things; he is a guide in human affairs.
Teacher of truth, he never ceases to admonish.
He makes wise the countenances of others; to them he gives a face; he leads them to develop it.
He opens their ears; he enlightens them.
He puts a mirror before others, he makes them prudent, cautious; he causes a face to appear on them.
He attends to things; he regulates their path, he arranges and commands.
He applies his light to the world.
Thanks to him people humanize their will and receive a strict education.
(Codice Matritense de la Real Academia, VIII,fol.118, r.- 118,v. trans. by Leon-Portilla 1963:10-11).

“Face and heart” (in ixtli in yollotl) expresses the notion of character (Leon-Portilla 1963). To possess a “perfected, wise face and good heart” is to exhibit sound judgment and sentiment: one’s psychological, intellectual, and physical behavior promotes balance-and-purity and averts imbalance-and-impurity. The person with “good heart, humane and stout” has is wise in the ways of teotl. The person lacking such a heart has an “enshrouded heart” (Leon-Portilla 1963:175). He is mad, foolish, and dull-witted.

The Nahuas likened the person with a “wise face and good heart” to well-formed quetzal plumage, jade, and turquoise. These objects faithfully and authentically present teotl’s balance-and-purity. They are green, the color of balance, purity, life, renewal, and well-being (Sahagun 1953-82:XI, pp.224,248). As one of Sahagun’s Nahua informants put it:

…the pure life is considered as a well-smoked, precious turquoise: as a round, reedlike, well-formed, precious green stone. There is no blotch, no blemish. Those perfect in their hearts, in their manner of life, those of pure life — like these are the precious green stone, the precious turquoise, which are glistening… They are those of pure life, those called good-hearted (Sahagun 1953-82:VI, p.113).

Living wisely also requires performing ritual activities devoted to restoring lost balance-and-purity or to averting future imbalance-and-impurity. Such activities included penitence, mortification, and “straightening one’s heart” (neyolmelahualiztli; “confession”) (Burkhart 1989:214). These helped restore balance to one’s heart by purifying it of tlazolli, by casting off tlatlacolli, and returning it to its proper shape. Humans also acquired moral “merit” through self-deprivation, moderation, and penitential self-denial.

7. Aesthetics

The Nahuas used the expression “flower and song” to refer to artistic activity and its products. Broadly construed, “flower and song” refers to creative activity generally including composing-performing song-poems, painting-writing, playing music, featherworking, and goldsmithing. However, translating-interpreting “flower and song” in this manner is potentially misleading. For the Nahuas did not have a concept of art in the modern Western sense of “art for art’s sake” i.e. in the sense that “art and works of art deserve the title by virtue of being products and activities with no other purpose than their contemplation” (Wilkinson 1998:383). Since the Nahuas did not produce objects soley for aesthetic contemplation, we might, then, rightly say that in this sense the Nahuas did not do or make art. They had no notion of a distinctly aesthetic — as opposed to moral or epistemological — point of view from which to judge the value (or beauty) of human creativity activity and its products. Rather, Nahua philosophers conceived aesthetics in terms of the problematic defining all philosophical speculation: helping humans maintain their balance on the slippery surface of the earth. As with all other human activities, creative activity and its products are meant to help humans maintain their balance and evaluated accordingly. Aesthetics is thus interwoven with moral and epistemological purposes. That which is aesthetically valuable (or beautiful) is also morally valuable and epistemologically valuable (and conversely). It is the well-rooted, well-balanced, true, disclosing, and pure. That which is aesthetically valueless (or ugly) is disordered, duplicitous, perverse, unbalanced, impure, and deceptive since unrooted, undisclosing, inauthentic, and false.

Nahuas aesthetics views creative activity and its products in the following terms. First, creative activity and its products are aesthetically valuable if and only if they genuinely present and truly disclose teotl. Like well-formed jade, turquoise, and quetzal plumes, they authentically unconceal balance-and-purity.

Secondly, creative activity and its products are aesthetically valuable if and only if they contribute positively to the existing store of balance-and-purity in the cosmos. Works of art accomplish this by faithfully presenting and hence actually embodying balance-and-purity, i.e. by literally being well-balanced and pure.

Third, aesthetically valuable creative activity and products must spring forth from a morally and epistemologically qualifed, “teotlized heart”, and hence burgeon from and be well-rooted in teotl. The accomplished artist is necessarily morally upright and knowledgable of teotl. Fools and rogues are incapable of creating beautiful works of art.

Fourth, aesthetically valuable creative activity and its products must have the appropriate effects upon their audience. Beautiful art improves and uplifts its audience psychologically, physically, morally, and epistemologically. It promotes psychological and physical balance-and-purity, moral righteousness, and proper understanding of teotl, and consequently helps humans attain greater degrees of humaness and well-being. By contrast, ugly art promotes physical and psychological imbalance-and-impurity, immorality, depravity, misunderstanding, and ill-being.

8. Conclusion

The ephemerality and fragility of earthly life loomed large over Conquest-era the Nahuatl-speaking peoples. Nahua wisdom aimed at enabling them to make the best of life under such circumstances by helping them to walk in balance upon the slippery earth. Walking in balance was simultaneously a moral, epistemological, practical, and aesthetic notion: it involved one’s being well-rooted, authentic, knowledgeable, true, pure, morally upright, and beautiful. A life wisely lived offered humans a fleeting, momentary repose from the inevitable sorrow, suffering, and transience of earthly existence. It enabled humans, if only momentarily, to flower and sing.

9. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

James Maffie
Email: maffiej@umd.edu
University of Maryland
U. S. A.