The Trinity

Christians believe that God is a Trinity of Persons, each omnipotent, omniscient and wholly benevolent, co-equal and fully divine. There are not three gods, however, but one God in three Persons: Father, Son and Holy Spirit. Prima facie, the doctrine more commonly known as the Trinity seems gratuitous: why multiply divine beings beyond necessity—especially since one God is hard enough to believe in? For Christians, however, the Trinity doctrine is neither gratuitous nor unmotivated. Claims about Christ’s divinity are difficult to reconcile with the Christian doctrine that there is just one God: Trinitarian theology is an attempt to square the Christian conviction that Jesus is the Son of God, fully divine yet distinct from his Father, with the Christian commitment to monotheism. Nevertheless, while the Trinity doctrine purports to solve a range of theological puzzles it poses a number of intriguing logical difficulties akin to those suggested by the identity of spatio-temporal objects through time and across worlds, puzzle cases of personal identity, and problems of identity and constitution. Philosophical discussions of the Trinity have suggested solutions to the Trinity puzzle comparable to solutions proposed to these classic identity puzzles. When it comes to the Trinity puzzle, however, one must determine whether such solutions accord with theological constraints.

History and Motivation
Theological Constraints
Philosophical Puzzles and Solutions
References and Further Reading

1. History and Motivation

a. Why Should One Believe It?

Why should one believe that God is a Trinity of Persons? Historically, most writers have held that even if the existence of God could be known by natural reason, his Trinitarian character could only be discovered through revelation. Such revelations in the tradition of the Church can only be indirectly encountered through the explication and interpretation of Scripture. This was, for example, Aquinas’ view. However, other writers have suggested that even discounting revelation, reflection on the nature of God should lead us to recognize his Trinitarian character. For instance, Richard Swinburne argues that there is at least a plausibility argument for a Trinity of divine persons insofar as God’s perfectly loving nature drives the production of the Trinitarian Persons:

I believe that there is overriding reason for a first divine individual to bring about a second divine individual and with him to bring about a third divine individual…[L]ove is a supreme good. Love involves sharing, giving to the other what of one’s own is good for him and receiving from the other what of his is good for one; and love involves co-operating with another to benefit third parties. [Richard Swinburne, The Christian God, p. 177-178]

However, this is a minority view, as other contemporary writers reject a prioriarguments for the doctrine of the Trinity. For example, Brian Leftow challenges it by asking why perfect love should stop at three rather than four or more.

If natural reason fails to provide a compelling reason to regard God as Trinitarian, an appeal to Scripture does not fare much better. There are few hints in the Bible of the Trinity doctrine, which developed later during the Patristic period. The Trinitarian formula figures in injunctions to baptize “in the name of the Father, Son and Holy Spirit” in Matthew 28:19, but both twofold and threefold patterns occur in the New Testament, and there is no mention of the Trinity as such. Rausch in The Trinitarian Controversy notes:

The binatarian formulas are found in Rom 8:11, 2 Cor. 4:14, Gal. 1:1, Eph. 1:20, 1 Tim. 1:2, 1 Pet. 1:21 and 2 John 1:13. The triadic schema is discovered in Matt. 28:19, 1 Cor. 6:11 and 12:4, Gal. 3:11-14, Heb. 10:29, and 1 Pet. 1:2. All these passages indicate that there is no fixity of wording. No doctrine of the Trinity in the Nicene sense is present in the New Testament. (William G. Rusch. The Trinitarian Controversy. Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1980. P. 2)

Despite this ambiguity, the Gospels do pose puzzles that motivate the development of Trinitarian doctrine. First, they represent Jesus as both the Son of Man, who prays to the Father, and as a divine being, identified in the Fourth Gospel with the Logos, who is “with God and is God,” [John 1:1] and who also announces that he and the Father are “one” [John 10:30]. Second, Scripture speaks of the Spirit who descended on Jesus’ disciples at Pentecost, and who also is conventionally identified with the Spirit that moved over the waters at Creation in Genesis. Arguably, we may regard the Trinity doctrine as an explanatory hypothesis, which purports to make sense of divinity claims concerning the Son and Holy Spirit without undermining the Judeo-Christian commitment to monotheism.

b. God and World: The Great Chain of Being and the Bright Line

The Trinity doctrine is also part of a larger theological project. In the early Christian Era of the Hebrew tradition, there was a plurality of divine, semi-divine and otherwise supernatural beings, which has to be reconciled with Hebraic monotheism. Some of these beings, such as Yahweh’s suite of Seraphim and Cherubim, are indigenous; others were absorbed from Hellenistic religious culture. In the interests of an orderly theological monotheism, these beings have to be defined in relation to God. Some were absorbed into the Godhead as aspects, powers or components of the one God, others were demoted to angelic or demonic status, and yet others were dismissed as the mere hypostatizations of theological façons de parler. The doctrine of the Trinity emerged as part of that theological tidying up process, which, from the Judeo-Christian side, was aimed at drawing a bright line between the one God and everything else.

If Jews and Christians (insofar as they were faithful to their Hebraic roots), were intent on separating out the one God from all other things visible and invisible, Greeks had no compunction about multiplying supernatural beings. Indeed, the Greek problem of “the one and the many” was one of filling the gap between a simple, impassible, atemporal, incorporeal, incorruptible deity and a world of matter, the passive recipient of form, which was temporal, corporeal, and corruptible.

The traditional response was to introduce one or more divine, semi-divine or otherwise supernatural beings to mediate between the One and the many. So Plato, in the Timaeus, speculated that the material world had been created by the Demiurge, a Second God. This strategy was elaborated upon during the late Hellenistic period in Gnostic systems, which introduced elaborate systems of “emanations” from the divine in a continuum, a Great Chain of Being that stretched from the most elevated of beings, through intermediaries, and to those who were sufficiently remote from full divinity to be involved with the world of matter. During the Hellenistic period, Christians and Jews engaged in philosophical theology, like Origen and Philo, adopted similar views since Philosophy was of the Greeks, and the philosophical lingua franca was Platonism.

In contrast, there was no reason to construct a Great Chain of Being within the Hebrew tradition. The writers of Hebrew Scripture did not have any compelling philosophical interests and did not look for mechanisms to explain how things came into being or operated: fiat was good enough. Perhaps more importantly, they did not view materiality as inherently imperfect or defective and so did not need to posit mediating beings to bridge an ontological gap between the divine and base matter, a feature of the Greek tradition. This tradition, though it continued to figure in popular piety, was officially repudiated by orthodox Christians. Yahweh, according to the Genesis accounts, created the world by fiat—no mechanism required—and saw that it was good.

For philosophical theologians in the grip of the problem of the One and the many, fiat would not do—and for Christian theologians, committed to monotheism, the doctrine of mediating divine or semi-divine beings posed special difficulties. As heirs to the Hebrew tradition, they recognized a fundamental ontological dividing line between a divine Creator and his creation and faced the problem of which side of the line the mediating being or beings occupied—exacerbated by the monotheistic assumption that there was only room for one Being on the side of the Creator.

c. Trinity East and West: Loose and Descending or Tight and Flat?

The Trinity Doctrine was an attempt to accommodate both partisans of the Bright Line and also partisans of the Great Chain of Being including Christians who identified Jesus with the Logos, a mediating divine being through which the material world was created. Jews wanted to absorb all divine beings into the one God in the interests of promoting monotheism; Greeks wanted mediating beings to bridge the ontological gap between the world of time and change, and the transcendent reality beyond. In identifying the Logos, incarnate in Christ, as the Second Person of the Trinity, Christians aimed to bridge the ontological gap with a mediating being who was himself incorporated into the Godhead, satisfying the metaphysical interests of both Greeks and Jews.

Elaborated over three centuries before reaching its mature form in the ecumenical councils of Nicea (325 AD) and Constantinople (381 AD), the doctrine of the Trinity represents an attempt to organize and make sense of the Christian conviction that God created the material world, sustained it and acted within history, most particularly through Christ and in his Church. On this account, God creates all things through the Logos and enters into the world in Christ. Jesus promises that he will not abandon his people but that after ascending to his Father will send the Holy Spirit to guide his Church. The Logos and Holy Spirit are not merely supernatural beings of an inferior order who do God’s business in the world: according to the Biblical tradition the material world is not an inferior realm to be handled by inferior mediating beings. Accordingly, Christians needed to hold that the Logos and Holy Spirit were fully divine. To preserve monotheism, however, there could not be divine beings other than God, so Christians were pressed to incorporate the Logos and Holy Spirit into the divine nature.

The tension between those two theological interests shaped the ongoing development of Trinitarian doctrine insofar as the goal of Christian orthodoxy was to make sense of the role of Christ as a mediating divine being—God with us, the Word made flesh through which all things were made—while maintaining the bright line between a transcendent, divine being and everything else in the interests of supporting monotheism. Painting with a broad brush, the former concern drove the development of Trinitarian doctrine that evolved into the Eastern tradition of Social Trinitarianism; the latter shaped the theology of Latin Trinitarianism that came to dominate the West.

Social Trinitarians, in the interests of explaining Christ’s mediating role, conceive of the Trinity as a divine society, each member of which is fully personal, each a center of consciousness, each involved in a loving relationship with the others. This view puts pressure on monotheism; however, advocates suggest that the cost is worth it in order to accommodate what they regard as compelling religious interests. Scripture represents Christ as communicating interpersonally with his Father, praying and being commended as the Son with whom his Father is well pleased. Social Trinitarians regard this sort of relationship as religiously important insofar as it models, in an ideal form, the relationship between God and us, and also between us and our fellows. In addition, the picture of the Trinity as a loving divine society makes sense of the notion of God as Love. For Social Trinitarians, in any case, the fundamental problem is one of making sense of the unity of Persons in one divine Being and this is, indeed, the project of the theologians credited with being the progenitors of Social Trinitarianism: the Cappadocian Fathers, Basil, Gregory of Nazianzus and Gregory of Nyssa.

Latin Trinitarians, by contrast, begin with the God’s unity as given and seek to explain how the Persons may be distinguished one from another. If Social Trinitarians understand the Trinity as a society of Persons, Latin Trinitarians represent the Trinity in toto as an individual and imagine the Persons generated in some manner by the relations among them. In this vein, St. Augustine suggests that the Trinity is analogous to the mind, its knowledge of itself and love of itself, which are distinct but inseparable (Augustine, On the Trinity). Nevertheless, while Latin Trinitarianism makes monotheism unproblematic, it poses difficulties concerning the apparently interpersonal communication between Jesus and his Father, and in addition raises questions about how the Persons, in particular the Holy Spirit, can be understood as personal.

Although Social Trinitarianism and Latin Trinitarianism fall within the scope of Nicene orthodoxy, it may be instructive to consider the difference in heterodox views that emerge in the East and West. When Social Trinitarianism goes bad it degrades into Subordinationism, a family of doctrines that assign an inferiority of being, status or role to the Son and Holy Spirit within the Trinity, which has its roots in the emanationist theologies that proliferated in the Hellenistic world. This view is classically represented in the theology of the heresiarch Arius, who held that the Son was a mere creature, albeit “the first-born of all creation.” Eastern theology tends towards a “loose,” descending Trinity, to tri-theism and subordinationism and so Arianism is the characteristic Eastern heresy.

Western theology, by contrast favors a “tight,” flat Trinity and in the first centuries of the Christian era tended toward ultra-high Christologies like Apollinarianism, the doctrine that, crudely, Jesus was a man in whom the Logos took the place normally occupied by a human rational soul, and Monophytism, according to which Christ had only one nature, and that divine. If the characteristic Trinitarian heresy in the East was Arianism, the characteristic Western heresies belong to a family of heterodox views generically known as Monarchianism, a term coined by Tertullian to designate tight-Trinity doctrines in virtue of their emphasis on the unity of God as the single and only ruler or source of Being, including most notably Modalism (a.k.a. Sabellianism), the doctrine that the Persons of the Trinity are merely “modes,” aspects or offices of the one God.

d. The Industry Standard: Nicea and Beyond

There is enough doctrinal space between Arianianism and Sabellianism to accommodate a range of theological accounts of the Trinity within the scope of Nicene orthodoxy. The Nicene formula declared that the Son was homoousios, “of the same substance” as the Father, which was elaborated by the Cappadocian Fathers in the dictum that the Persons of the Trinity were one ousia but three hypostases. This knocked out Arians on the one side and Sabellians on the other, but left room for a range of interpretations in between since “ousia” was, notoriously, ambiguous. Aristotle had used the term to designate both individuals, substances that are bearers of essences and properties, and the essential natures of individuals, the natural kinds in virtue of which they are substances in the first sense. So, individual human beings are substances in the first sense, and the human nature they share, the natural kind to which they belong, is a substance in the second sense.

The Nicene homoousios formula inherited the ambiguity. Understood in one way, the claim that the Persons of the Trinity were “homoousios” said that the Persons were the same individual, skating dangerously close to the Sabellian claim that they were “monoousios”—of one substance. Understood in the other way, it said merely that they were of the same kind, an interpretation compatible with tri-theism. The Cappadocians attempted to clarify and disambiguate the Nicene formula by employing the term “hypostasis,” used earlier by Origen, to capture the notion of individual identity rather than identity of kind. By itself, this did not solve the problem. First, apart from their revisionary theological usage, ousia and hypostasis were virtual synonyms: as a solution to the Trinity puzzle this formula was rather like saying that the Persons were one thing but different objects. Secondly, “one ousia” still failed to rule out tri-theism—indeed, in non-theological cases, one ousia, many hypostases is precisely what different individuals of the same species are. Homoousios, as intended, ruled out the doctrine that Father and Son were merely similar kinds of beings—homoiousios—but it did not rule out their being distinct individuals of the same kind.

The Cappadocian dictum, however, provided a framework for further discussion of the Trinity puzzle: the Trinitarian Persons were to be understood as being the same something but different something-elses and the substantive theological question was that of characterizing the ways in which they were bound together and individuated.

As to the latter question, Nicea opened the discussion of the “theology” of the Trinity, understood as the exploration of the relations amongst Persons—the “immanent Trinity” as distinct from the “economic Trinity,” that is the Trinity understood in terms of the distinct roles of the Persons in their worldly activities, in creation, redemption and sanctification. Nicea cashed out the homoousios claim by noting that the Son was “begotten, not made” indicating that he was, as noted in a parallel formula then current, “out of the Father’s ousia.” Furthermore, the Holy Spirit was declared at Constantinople to have the same sort of ontological status as the Son. So in the Fourth Century, at the Councils of Nicea and Constantinople, and through the work of the Cappadocians, the agenda for Trinitarian theology was set and the boundaries of orthodoxy were marked.

Within these parameters, the Trinity doctrine poses problems of three sorts: first, theological problems in reconciling theological doctrines concerning the character and properties of God with Trinitarian claims; secondly, theological puzzles that arise from Christological claims in particular; and finally logical puzzles posed by the Trinity doctrine itself. It remains to be seen whether it is possible to formulate a coherent doctrine of the Trinity within the constraints of Christian orthodoxy.

2. Theological Constraints

a. Monotheism

Christians claim to be monotheists and yet, given the doctrine of the Trinity, hold that there are three beings who are fully divine, viz. God the Father, Son and Holy Spirit. The first Trinity puzzle is that of explaining how we can attribute full divinity to the Persons of the Trinity without either compromising monotheism or undermining claims about the distinctness of Trinitarian persons.

Orthodox accounts of the Trinity hover uneasily between Sabellianism—which construes Trinitarian Persons as mere phases, aspects or offices of one God—and tri-theism, according to which the Persons are three Gods. Tri-theism is unacceptable since it is incompatible with the historical Christian commitment to monotheism inherited from the Hebrew tradition.

The fundamental problem for Trinitarian orthodoxy is to develop a doctrine of the Trinity that fits in the space between Sabellianism (or other versions of Monarchianism) and tri-theism. For Social Trinitarians in particular the problem has been one of articulating an account of the Trinity that affirms the individuality of the Persons and their relationships with one another without lapsing into tri-theism.

b. The Distinctness of Persons

Historically, Monarchianism—in particular Modalism (or Sabellianism), the doctrine that the Persons are “modes,” aspects, or roles of God—has been more tempting to Christians than tri-theism. The fundamental problem orthodox Latin Trinitarians face is that of maintaining a distinction between Trinitarian Persons sufficient to avoid Sabellianism, since orthodox Christians hold that the Persons of the Trinity are not merely aspects of God or God under different descriptions but in some sense distinct individuals such that Father ≠ Son ≠ Holy Spirit.

Christians hold that there are properties that distinguish the Persons. First, there are intra–Trinitarian relational properties the Persons have in virtue of their relations to other Trinitarian Persons: the Father begets the Son, but the Son does not beget the Son; the Spirit proceeds from the Father (and the Son) but neither the Father nor the Son proceeds from the Father (and the Son). Secondly, the Persons of the Trinity are distinguished in virtue of their distinctive “missions”—their activities in the world. The Second Person of the Trinity becomes incarnate, is born, suffers, dies, is buried, rises from the dead and ascends to the Father. According to orthodox doctrine, however, the same is not true of the Father (or Holy Spirit) and, indeed, the doctrine that the Father became incarnate, suffered and died is the heresy of patripassionism.

According to Latin Trinitarians, God, the Trinity, is an individual rather than a community of individuals sharing the same divine nature and each Person of the Trinity is that individual. Given this account however, the trick is to block inferences from the ascription of properties characteristic of one Trinitarian Person to the ascription of those properties to other Persons. Moreover, since it is held that the Persons cannot be individuated by their worldly activities, Latin Trinitarians, whose project is to explain the distinctions between Persons, must develop an account of the intra–Trinitarian relations that distinguish them—a project which is at best speculative.

c. The Equality of Persons, the Descending Trinity and the Filioque Clause

Supposing that we tread the fine line, and succeed in affirming both the participation of Trinitarian Persons in one God and their distinctness. Orthodoxy then requires, in addition, that we hold the Persons of the Trinity to be equal in power, knowledge, goodness and all properties pertaining to divinity other than those that are specific to the Persons individually. This poses problems when it comes to divine agency. Assuming that doing A and doing A* are equally good, it is logically possible that one Person may prefer A while another prefers A* (and that the third is, perhaps, indifferent). In the absence of a tie-breaker, it is hard to see how the Trinity can get anything done! If the Person who prefers A and the Person who prefers A* stick to their guns, neither can accomplish his end so it would seem, neither can count as omnipotent; if they defer to one another they also end up in a deadlock.

This is a difficulty for Social Trinitarians in particular insofar as they understand the Trinitarian Persons as distinct centers of consciousness and will whose projects might be incompatible. Swinburne, a Social Trinitarian, attempts to avoid this difficulty by suggesting that the Father, in virtue of his character as the Source of Trinitarian Persons, has the authority to “lay down the rules” so that irresolvable conflicts amongst Trinitarian Persons will be avoided (Swinburne, pp. 172-173). If however we assume that the preferences of one Trinitarian person take precedence so that the other Persons willingly defer to him as a matter of policy, then it is hard to avoid the suspicion that some Persons of the Trinity are “more equal than others”—the heresy of Subordinationism.

Even if Social Trinitarians avoid Subordinationism, the descending account of the Trinity according to which the defining characteristic of the Father is that of being the Source of Trinitarian Persons has theological ramifications which, in the end, resulted in the defining controversy between Eastern and Western churches concerning the Filioque clause. The original version of the Creed formulated by the councils of Nicea and Constantinople, declares that the Holy Spirit proceeds from the Father (ek tou Patros ek poreuomenon). The Filioque Clause, affirming that the Holy Spirit proceeds from the Father and the Son (ex Patri Filioque procedit), which first appeared in the profession of faith formulated at the Council of Toledo in 589, spread throughout Gaul and eventually become normative in the West, was firmly rejected by the Eastern churches on the grounds that it undermined the doctrine that the Father was the Source of Trinitarian Persons and the personality of the Holy Spirit.

Photios, the 9^th Century Patriarch of Constantinople who initiated the Photian Schism between East and West, argues in The Mystogogy of the Holy Spirit that the procession of the Holy Spirit from the Son as well as the Father implies that the Father is not up to the task of generating Trinitarian Persons. Either the Father can do the job on his own or he can’t. If he can, then the participation of the Son in the generation of the Holy Spirit is superfluous and so there is no reason to accept the Filioque Clause. If he can’t, then he is a theological failure, which is absurd. Photios, representing the Eastern tradition, assumes a descending account of the Trinity according to which the characteristic hypostatic property of the Father is his role as the Source of the other Trinitarian Persons. He assumes in addition that all properties of Trinitarian Persons are such that they are either generic properties of divinity, and so are shared by all Persons, or hypostatic properties possessed uniquely by the Persons they characterize. It follows from these assumptions that the Filioque Clause should be rejected.

Photios and other Eastern theologians worried also that the Western account of the Trinity undermined the personal character of the Holy Spirit. According to one metaphor, widely employed in the West, the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are analogous to the Lover, the Beloved and the Love between them. Love is not the sort of thing that can have psychological properties or count as a person and so Eastern theologians charged that the “flat” Trinitarian picture that dominated Western Trinitarian theology, in which the Holy Spirit was understood as a relation or mediator between Father and Son undermined the personhood of the Holy Spirit.

Is the “descending” picture at the heart of Eastern Trinitarian theology, according to which the Father is characteristically the progenitor of Trinitarian Persons, inherently subordinationist? It does not seem to be so since there is no compelling reason why we should regard the property of being the Source of Trinitarian persons as one that confers superior status or authority on its possessor. Some parents are smarter, better looking, and richer than their children; others are dumber, uglier, and poorer. When children are young their parents legitimately exercise authority over them; when they are grown up they become their parents’ peers. To the extent that the role of the Father as the Source of Trinitarian Persons is analogous to human parenthood there is no reason to regard the Father as in any respect superior to the other Persons and it is hard to see what other reason could be given for this view.

Nevertheless, the descending Trinity picture lends itself to subordinatist interpretations in a way that the flat Trinity model does not. So when, for example, Swinburne suggests that the Father’s essential character as Source of Trinitarian Persons confers on him the authority to resolve intra–Trinitarian disputes or entitles him to the deference of other Trinitarian Persons he is, at the very least, skating close to the edge of Subordinationism.

d. Personality

Finally, Christians hold that God is personal—the subject of psychological states. But what is personal: the Trinity in toto or the Persons individually? The Litany, which addresses the Persons individually, and the Trinity in toto suggests all of the above:

O God the Father, Creator of heaven and earth; Have mercy upon us.
O God the Son, Redeemer of the world; Have mercy upon us.
O God the Holy Ghost, Sanctifier of the faithful; Have mercy upon us.
O holy, blessed, and glorious Trinity, one God: Have mercy upon us.

But this does not seem to be a coherent position. If the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are distinct centers of consciousness, the sorts of beings to whom one can reasonably appeal for mercy, and the Trinity is a divine society as Social Trinitarians suggest, it would seem that the Trinity could not itself be personal in any robust sense. After invoking the Father, Son and Holy Ghost, the invocation of the Trinity seems superfluous—as if I were to ask permission to build a fence on our adjoining property lines from each of my neighbors and then get them together to ask permission of them as a group.

On the face of it Latin Trinitarians have an easier time explaining what is personal: it is God, the Trinity and the Persons are individually personal to the extent that each is God. The Father is God so insofar as God, the Trinity, is personal, the Father is personal; the Son and Holy Spirit are God so they too are personal. The invocations in the Litany are indeed redundant because all four invoke no one other than God, but that is just a matter of poetic license. Nevertheless, some Christians, in particular Eastern Christians who are sympathetic to the Social Trinitarianism, worry that some metaphors Latin Trinitarians exploit undermine the personal character of the Holy Spirit. In addition, Latin Trinitarianism makes Gospel accounts of Jesus’ praying to the Father difficult to make out. Who was praying to whom? On the Latin Trinitarian account it seems that, insofar as we identify Jesus with the Second Person of the Trinity, God was simply talking to himself.

e. Christology and the Jesus Predicate Problem

The doctrine of the Trinity, as noted earlier, is motivated by the Christian conviction that Jesus was, in some sense, divine. Jesus however was born, suffered under Pontius Pilate, was crucified, died and was buried; he did not understand Chinese; he believed that David was the author of all the Psalms. These properties are, it would seem, incompatible with divinity and, indeed, there appear to be a great many predicates that are true of Jesus which, it would seem, could not be true of God and vice versa.

This is the Jesus Predicate Problem: we do not want to ascribe all the predicates that are true of Jesus to God simpliciter or, in particular, to God the Father. We do not, for example, want to hold that the Father suffered on the Cross—the heresy of Patripassionism. God, as traditionally understood is impassible—he cannot be subject to suffering, pain or harm. Moreover God has no beginning in time or end, and is, according to most orthodox accounts atemporal insofar as he is eternal rather than merely everlasting: he exists outside of time in what is, from the perspective of his subjectivity, the eternal now. Jesus however was born at a particular time and lived his life in time, so to maintain God’s atemporality, we cannot allow predicates that assign temporal properties to Jesus to God, or in particular to God the Father. In general, there are a range of predicates that are true of Jesus that, we want to hold, are not true of God the Father or of the Holy Spirit, and which we would hesitate to ascribe to God simpliciter insofar as they appear to be inconsistent with essential features of divinity.

To avoid the migration of Jesus’ predicates to other Persons of the Trinity, we need to create enough logical space between the Persons to block inferences from claims about Jesus to claims about the Father so that, in general, “Jesus Fs” does not entail “God the Father Fs” where “x Fs” says either that x has a property, is a certain kind of thing or does a certain kind of action. The trouble with Monarchian accounts, which make the Trinity “too tight,” is that they obliterate the logical space between the Persons that would block such inferences. Since Monarchians cannot use Trinitarian doctrine to block these inferences they use Christology to do the job—by either adopting very high Christologies or very low ones. The wedge has to be driven somewhere and, if there isn’t enough logical space to drive it in between the First and Second Persons of the Trinity, it has to go in between the Second Person, the divine Logos which is from the beginning with God and is God, and whatever it is that is the subject of Jesus predicates.

One way to do this is via an ultra-high Christology according to which the troublesome Jesus predicates aren’t literally true of Christ the divine Logos but are true of something else—the human body he animates, a mere appearance or an imposter. To see how this works, consider Apollarianism, an ultra-high Christology rejected at the Council of Constantinople in 381 and again at the Council of Chalcedon in 451 at which Christological doctrine was formulated. According to this heterodox view, the historical Jesus was a human being who had the Logos plugged into the place that would normally be occupied by a human rational soul. Christ is the Logos and, insofar we ascribe such Jesus predicates as “___ suffered under Pontius Pilate,” “___ was crucified,” “___ died” and “___ was buried” that is merely a façon de parler. Strictly speaking, what these predicates are true of is not Christ but only of the body he used for a time to conduct his worldly operations. Consequently, they do not pass to the Logos or to other Persons of the Trinity, so there is no problem.

The other way to drive the wedge between the Father and the bearer of Jesus predicates is by adopting an ultra-low Christology, that is, by kicking Christ out of the Godhead altogether. Historically, this is the tack taken by Adoptionists who held that the man Jesus became “Son of God” only by adoption and grace dispensed at by God at his baptism, and the view held by contemporary quasi-Christians who deny the divinity of Christ. If Christ, the bearer of Jesus predicates is not divine, problematic Jesus predicates do not pass to the Father, or to God simpliciter, so there is no problem.

Interestingly, Christians have historically rejected ultra-high Christologies on the grounds that they undermine soteriology. This concern was articulated by Gregory of Nazianzus in his critique of Apollinarianism by the dictum “non assumptus, non salus.” The idea is that God’s aim in becoming incarnate was to assume human nature in order to heal it—if Christ only seemed to be human that could not be accomplished. And if he only took on a human body and its vegetative and animal souls—the principles responsible for life, growth, locomotion and emotion—but not the rational soul of a human being, he would have left out the very component of humanness that was in need of healing, since it was precisely man’s rational nature that was corrupted by sin. Anselm makes the same point in Cur Deus Homo? Whatever we think of this sort of argument it was for this reason that Christians worried about Christologies that failed to recognize the full humanity of Christ.

Christians who could not accept either ultra-high or ultra-low Christologies attempted to circumvent the Jesus Predicate Problem by rejecting the ultra-tight Monarchian view of the Trinity. So, writing more than a century before Nicea, Hippolytus suggested that Hereclitean contradictions could be avoided by a Trinitarian doctrine that created enough logical space between the Persons to block inferences from the character of Christ, the Second Person of the Trinity, to claims about the character of the other Persons, the Father in particular. With sufficient logical space between the Persons, Christ’s vincibility, mortality and other properties that are prima facie incompatible with divinity or unworthy of a deity can be segregated so that they don’t transfer to the Father. Given a Subordinationist account on the descending model according to which the Second Person is a semi-divine mediating figure there is no problem assigning troublesome Jesus predicates to him.

The trouble is that once committed to the Nicene doctrine that Christ is wholly divine, consubstantial with and equal to the Father, “God of God, Light of Light, very God of very God,” the same problem arises all over again for the Second Person of the Trinity! If ascribing these properties to the Father is bad, ascribing them to the Son thus understood is just as bad. Historically, the Church’s way with Jesus predicate problems that threaten the doctrine of the Trinity has been to recharacterize them as Christological problems concerning the relation between Christ’s divine and human natures—which are beyond the scope of this essay.

We may ask however whether, once the Church’s Trinity theologians circumvent the Jesus Predicate Problem by passing the buck to the Christologists, there is any reason to worry about Modalism or other tight-Trinity doctrines that minimize the logical space between Persons. As we have seen, historically, the rationale for rejecting Sabellianism was the worry that it did not leave enough space to drive a wedge between Father and Son that would block inferences from “Jesus Fs” to “God the Father Fs.” If however we can contrive a theological account that blocks such inferences Christologically, by driving the wedge between the bearer of Jesus predicates and the Second Person of the Trinity—by, e.g. distinguishing between Christ’s divine and human natures or between Christ qua human and Christ qua God—then there is no particular reason to worry about the space between Trinitarian Persons, and so it may be that Sabellianism is a more attractive proposition than it was initially through to be.

3. Philosophical Puzzles and Solutions

For Christians, at least in the West, Quincunque Vult, commonly known as the Athanasian Creed, defines Trinitarian orthodoxy as follows:

We worship one God in Trinity, and Trinity in Unity, neither confounding the Persons, nor dividing the Substance
For there is one Person of the Father, another of the Son, and another of the Holy Ghost…
Such as the Father is, such is the Son, and such is the Holy Ghost…
[T]he Father is God, the Son is God, and the Holy Ghost is God.
And yet they are not three Gods, but one God

Christians are thus committed to the following claims:

(1) The Father is God

(2) The Son is God

(3) The Holy Spirit is God

(4) The Father is not the Son

(5) The Father is not the Holy Spirit

(6) The Son is not the Holy Spirit

(7) There is exactly one God

a. Trinity and Identity

Can one consistently believe (1) – (7)? It depends on how we read the “is” in (1) – (6). If we read it throughout as the “is” of strict identity, as “=” the answer is no. Identity is an equivalence relation: it is reflexive, symmetric and transitive, which is to say, for all x, y and z the following hold:

Reflexivity: x = x

Symmetry: If x = y then y = x

Transitivity: If x = y and y = z then x = y

In addition, identity is an unrestricted indiscernibilty relation for all properties, which is to say it obeys Leibniz’ Law, understood as the Indiscernibility of Identicals:

LL: If x = y then for all properties, P, x has P if and only if y has P

This is bad news. Suppose we read the “is” as “=” in (1) – (6). Then it follows from (1) and (2), by symmetry and transitivity, that the Father is the Son, which contradicts (4). Put another way, given LL, (1) entails that God has all the same properties as the Father, including the property of being identical with the Father insofar as everything has the property of self-identity. (2) says that the Son likewise has all the same properties as God. It follows that, since God has the property of being identical with the Son, the Son also has the property of being identical with the Father, which contradicts (4).

These formal features of identity are non-negotiable in the way that the four-sidedness of squares is: God cannot evade them any more than he can make a square with only three sides. God can make triangles—and pentagons, chiliagons or figures with any number of sides he pleases—but he cannot make such things squares. So, assuming that “God,” “Father,” “Son” and “Holy Spirit” don’t change their reference, the “is” that figures in (1) – (6) cannot be the “is” of strict identity.

b. The “Is” of Predication

In English, most of the time the word “is” occurs it does not express an identity. The “is” that occurs in (8) and (9) is the “is” of predication: it is used to ascribe a property to an object:

(8) Ducati is a dog.

(9) Ducati is canine.

(8) is not an identity statement because “a dog” does not pick out a particular object. Identity is a relation between objects; in particular, it is the relation that everything bears to itself and to no other thing. In a true identity statement the nouns or noun phrases on either sides of the identity pick out the very same thing. (10) and (11) are true identity statements:

(10) Ducati is the chocolate Lab at 613 Second Avenue.

(11) Ducati is Britynic Cadbury of Bourneville

“The chocolate Lab at 613 Second Avenue” and “Britynic Cadbury of Bourneville” each pick out particular dog, as it happens, the same dog that “Ducati” picks out but “a dog” does not. (8) in fact says the same thing as (9)—it says that Ducati has the property of being a dog, that is the property of being canine. The “is” in (8), like the “is” in (9) is therefore, the “is” of predication.

Now consider (1) – (3) understanding the “is” that occurs in each sentence as the “is” of predication to yield:

(1′) The Father is a God

(2′) The Son is a God

(3′) The Holy Spirit is a God

The “is” of predication does not express an equivalence relation and, in general, “x has P” and “y has P” do not imply “x is identical to y.” Ducati is a dog and Riley is a dog but it does not follow that Ducati is (identical to) Riley—in fact they are not. Similarly, (1′) and (2′) do not imply that the Father is the Son so there is no contradiction.

However, (1′) – (3′) just say that the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are each divine, in the way that (8) just says that Ducati is canine, and this leaves open the possibility that there are two, or three Gods involved. They do not explain what makes the Persons one God or provide any rationale for (7). Furthermore, together with (4) – (6) it seems to follow that there are indeed three Gods, just as it follows from “Ducati is a dog,” “Riley is a dog” and “Ducati is not Riley” that there are (at least) two dogs.

This is the concern Gregory of Nyssa addressed in his response to Ablabius, who worried that understanding the unity of Trinitarian persons in terms of their sharing the property of divinity implied Tri-theism:

The argument which you state is something like this: Peter, James, and John, being in one human nature, are called three men: and there is no absurdity in describing those who are united in nature, if they are more than one, by the plural number of the name derived from their nature. If, then, in the above case, custom admits this, and no one forbids us to speak of those who are two as two, or those who are more than two as three, how is it that in the case of our statements of the mysteries of the Faith, though confessing the Three Persons, and acknowledging no difference of nature between them, we are in some sense at variance with our confession, when we say that the Godhead of the Father and of the Son and of the Holy Ghost is one, and yet forbid men to say “there are three Gods”? The question is, as I said, very difficult to deal with. (Gregory of Nyssa, “To Ablabius”)

This is a difficult question indeed.

c. Divine Stuff: ‘God’ as a Mass Term

Gregory proposed the following analogy by way of a solution:

That which is not thus circumscribed is not enumerated, and that which is not enumerated cannot be contemplated in multitude. For we say that gold, even though it be cut into many figures, is one, and is so spoken of, but we speak of many coins or many staters, without finding any multiplication of the nature of gold by the number of staters; and for this reason we speak of gold, when it is contemplated in greater bulk, either in plate or in coin, as “much,” but we do not speak of it as “many golds” on account of the multitude of the material,-except when one says there are “many gold pieces” (Darics, for instance, or staters), in which case it is not the material, but the pieces of money to which the significance of number applies: indeed, properly, we should not call them “gold” but “golden.” As, then, the golden staters are many, but the gold is one, so too those who are exhibited to us severally in the nature of man, as Peter, James, and John, are many, yet the man in them is one. (Gregory of Nyssa. “To Ablabius”)

What Gregory has noticed here is that “gold” is a mass term rather than a count noun. Mass terms have a number of features that distinguish them from count nouns: in particular, they do not take plural, so to that extent as Gregory remarks, “gold…is one.” Intuitively, count nouns designate “things” while mass terms designate “stuffs”—gold, water, oatmeal and the like.

However, Gregory has inferred that human nature and, by analogy, divinity, should be understood as stuff too so that, just as there is one gold, parceled up into bits that are not properly speaking “gold” but merely golden there is just one man parceled up into bits each of which is not, properly speaking, man but merely human.

Richard Cartwright dismisses this solution very quickly as desperate, heretical and unhelpful:

It seems to have been left to Gregory of Nyssa, Basil’s younger brother, to notice that, thus understood, consubstantiality of the Father, the Son, and the Holy Spirit appears to license saying that there are three Gods. Gregory himself rather desperately suggested that strictly speaking there is only one man. But besides being itself heretical, the suggestion is of no help. (Richard Cartwright. “On the Logical Problem of the Trinity” in Richard Cartwright, Philosophical Essays. MIT Press, 1987. P. 171)

Nevertheless, it may be possible to push a little further along this line. Even though, intuitively, we think of mass nouns as designating more or less homogeneous stuffs, without perceptible, discrete but continuous parts, mass noun is a grammatical category and does not determine the character of what it designates but how we talk about it. The designata of some mass nouns have quite large, readily perceptible discrete parts. Consider “fruit” which, in English typically functions as a mass noun: the plural form, “fruits” is not ill-formed but it is rare and occurs primarily in idioms like “by their fruits ye shall know them”; we say “a lot of fruit” but only rarely “a few fruits” or “many fruits.” Perhaps most tellingly “fruit” takes what are called “sortalizing auxiliary nouns,” devices that attach to mass terms to yield noun phrases that behave like +count nouns: so we talk about “bodies of water,” “piles of sand” and, tellingly, “pieces of fruit.” From the grammatical point of view, Gregory’s revisionary proposal is in order: we can by an act of linguistic legislation decide to treat, perhaps for convenience, “human” as a mass term designating a spatially extended but gappy object, so that Peter, James and John are not, properly speaking, humans but rather pieces of humanity, a stuff which consists of Peter, James, John and all their fellows pooled together.

Perhaps the Trinity can be fixed by an account along the lines of Gregory’s proposal, according to which we may understand the God as a concrete but non-spatio-temporal whole, whose simple, non-spatio-temporal parts are the Trinitarian Persons. If so, then noting that parts need not be spatio-temporal, we might reconstruct (1) – (7) as follows:

(1”) The Father is a part of God

(2”) The Son is a part of God

(3”) The Holy Spirit is a part of God

(4”) The Father is not the same part of God as the Son

(5”) The Father is not the same part of God as the Holy Spirit

(6”) The Son is not the same part of God as the Holy Spirit

(7) There is exactly one God

(1”) – (7) are clearly consistent. Moreover if we remember that “God” is being treated as a mass term, designating all the divinity there is, in the way that “water” designates all the world’s water, of which lakes, rivers and puddles are parts, there is no difficulty in holding that the Persons are equally divine. Every body of water however small is thoroughly H₂O: the humblest puddle is as watery as the Pacific Ocean and so, to that extent, water is wholly present in each of its parts. Similarly we can say that each Person is thoroughly God: divinity is wholly present in each of its (non-spatio-temporal) parts.

d. Relative Identity

Gregory’s proposal has not received widespread attention. However a comparable proposal, viz. that the “is” in (1) to (6) be construed as designating relative identity relations, has been widely discussed and solutions to the Trinity puzzle that make this move have been proposed by Peter Geach and more recently by Peter Van Inwagen.

According to Geach, identity statements of the form “x is identical with y” are incomplete: they are elliptical for “x is the same F as y” where F is a sortal term, that is a count noun that conveys criteria of identity. So common nouns like “table,” “man,” and “set” are sortals: grammatically they are count nouns and semantically they, in effect, provide instructions about how to identify them, how to chop out the hunk of the world they fill, how to distinguish them from other objects and how to trace their histories to determine when (if ever) they come into being and when (if ever) they cease to exist. Defenders of the relative identity thesis suggest that we cannot obey the instruction to “count all the things in this room” because “thing” does not convey identity criteria. If I am to count things, I need to know what sorts of things should I count? If I am asked whether this is the same as that, before I can answer I have to ask, “The same what?”

Geach notes further that, where F and G are sortals, it is possible to have cases where some x and y are the same F but not the same G. So, for example, we may want to say that 2/3 is the same rational number as 4/6 but not the same ordered pair of integers or that two copies of Ulysses are the same literary work but not the same book.

Finally, sortal-relative-identity relations are equivalence relations but they are not indiscernibility relations for all properties unrestrictedly. For any sortal-relative-identity relation, being-the-same-F-as, there is a set of predicates, S_F, the indiscernibility set for F, such that for any predicate P Î S_F, if x is the same F as y then x has P if and only if y has P. For predicates P* Ï S_F the inferences from x is the same F as y and x has P* to y has P* and vice versa do not go through.

Now as regards the Trinity puzzle we note that “god” and “person” are sortals and hence that given Geach’s suggestion the following claims are consistent:

(1_R) The Father is the same god as God

(2_R) The Son is the same god as God

(3_R) The Holy Spirit is the same god as God

(4_R) The Father is not the same divine person as the Son

(5_R) The Father is not the same divine person as the Holy Spirit

(6_R) The Son is not the same divine person as the Holy Spirit

The relative identity account of Trinitarian claims is similar to the reconstruction of Trinitarian claims in (1”) – (6”) insofar as rely on the strategy of invoking different relations in the first and last three statements: the relations of being-part-of-the-same-whole-as and being-the-same-part-as are different to one another as are the relations of being-the-same-god-as and being-the-same-divine-person-as. Consequently, (1_R) – (6_R) are consistent with (7). Sortals, as noted, provide rules for counting. Counting by book, two copies of Ulysses count as two; counting by literary work, they count as one. Similarly, the suggestion is that counting by divine person, the Father, Son and Holy Spirit count as three but counting by god they count as one and so we can affirm (7): there is exactly one God. The relative identity strategy thus avoids Tri-theism.

The relative identity strategy also circumvents the Jesus Predicate Problem, at least to the extent that we want to block inferences from “The Son Fs” to “The Father Fs” for a range of predicates including “became incarnate,” “was crucified,” “suffered under Pontius Pilate” and the like. To block objectionable inferences we note that these predicates do not fall within the indiscernibility set for divine person and so the relative identity strategy avoids Patripassionism.

In addition, on this account, we can explain why (1_R) – (3_R) entail that the Father, Son and Holy Spirit each have those properties that are constituitive of full divinity. We note that “is omnipotent,” “is omniscient,” “is omnibenevolent” and other generically divine properties are in the indiscernibillity set for god so that given God has the properties they designate we may infer that the same is true of the Father, Son and Holy Spirit. Intuitively, there are generically divine properties, designated by predicates in the indiscernibility set for for god, which all Trinitarian Persons have in virtue of (1_R) – (3_R) and there are hypostatic properties which each Person has in virtue of being the Person he is.

Relative identity is however a controversial doctrine in its own right and, even if we accept the metaphysical baggage it carries, may not suitable for theological purposes. So Michael Rae worries that relative identity commits one to a theologically disastrous antirealistism:

Many philosophers are attracted to antirealism, but accepting it as part of a solution to the problem of the Trinity is disastrous. For clearly orthodoxy will not permit us to say that the very existence of Father, Son, and Holy Spirit is a theory-dependent matter. Nor will it permit us to say that the distinctness of the divine Persons is somehow relative to our ways of thinking or theorizing. The latter appears to be a form of modalism. And yet it is hard to see how it could be otherwise if Geach’s theory of relative identity is true. For what else could it possibly mean to say that there is simply no fact about whether Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are the same thing as one another, the same thing as God, or, indeed, the same thing as Baal. (Michael Rae, “Relative Identity and the Doctrine of the Trinity,” Philosophia Christi vol. 5, No. 2)

e. The Trinity and Other Identity Puzzles

The logical problem of the Trinity arises because, as we have seen in 3.a, (1) – (7) are inconsistent if the “is” that figures in them is interpreted as the “is” of (absolute) identity. In this respect, the Trinity puzzle is comparable to a range of puzzles concerning the identity of ordinary material objects.

One range of such puzzles concerns the problem of material composition. A lump of clay is made into a statue. The statue and the lump occupy exactly the same spatial region so we want to say that they are they are the same thing and that there is just one material object in the region “they” occupy: we balk at the idea of more than one material object occupying exactly the same place. But the statue and the clay do not have all the same properties: the statue was formed by the sculptor but the lump was not; the lump can survive the most radical changes in shape, including changes that would transform it into a different statue but the statue cannot. Consequently we cannot hold that there is a statue and a lump of clay and that they are strictly identical without falling afoul of Leibniz’ Law. We want to say that the statue and clay count as one material object but we are barred from holding that they are strictly identical. In this respect the problem of material composition poses the same problem as the Trinity doctrine: we want to say the Persons are one God but we are barred, in this case by theological concerns, from saying that they are strictly identical.

The problem posed by the material composition and other identity puzzles, including the Ship of Theseus and the problem of the dividing self which figures in discussions of personal identity, is that there are a great many cases where we want to say that objects x and y are the same thing but where the relation between x and y is such that it violates the formal features of identity—either because it is one-many rather than one-one or because it is not an unrestricted indiscernibility relation. And this is precisely the problem posed by the doctrine of the Trinity.

It was noted above that the proposal in 3.b, that the “is” in (1) – (3) should be interpreted as the “is” of predication, is also unacceptable because it is tri-theistic. It was also noted that the accounts suggested in 3.c and 3.d are not overtly incoherent but ultimately depend respectively on whether a mereology and an account of relative are workable. The relative identity account has been discussed extensively in the literature. The worry about the relative identity account is not that it fails to produce the right results as regards the doctrine of the Trinity, but that relative identity is itself a questionable business and in any case carries metaphysical baggage that may be theologically unacceptable.

The moral of this story should perhaps be that “identity,” as Frege famously remarked, “gives rise to challenging questions which are not altogether easy to answer” (Gottlob Frege, “On Sense and Reference”). For all that critics have ridiculed the doctrine of the Trinity as a prime example of the absurdity of Christian doctrine—as the late Bishop Pike did when he suggested that the Trinity was “a sort of committee god”—Trinity talk is no worse off than much non-theological talk about the identities of non-divine persons and ordinary material objects.

4. References and Further Readings

Augustine. “On the Trinity.” The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
Baber, H. E. “Sabellianism Reconsidered.” in Sophia vol. 41, No. 2 (October 2002): 1-18.
Baber, H. E. “Trinity, Filioque and Semantic Ascent” forthcoming in Sophia.
Bobrinskoy, Boris. The Mystery of the Trinity. Crestwood, NY: St. Vladimir’s Seminary press, 1999.
Brower, Jeffrey E. and Michael C. Rea. “Material Constitution and the Trinity.” Faith and Philosophy 22 (2005): 57-76.
Brown, David. The Divine Trinity. London: Duckworth, 1985.
Cartwright, Richard. “On the Logical Problem of the Trinity.” In Philosophical Essays. The MIT Press, 1990.
Davis, Stephen T., Kendall, Daniel, S.J., and O’Collins, Gerald, S.J., eds. The Trinity. An Interdisciplinary Symposium on the Trinity. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Gregory of Nyssa. “To Ablabius.” The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
Hebblethwaite, Brian. Philosophical Theology and Christian Doctrine. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing Ltd, 2005. Esp. Ch. 5: “Trinity.”
Hippolytus, Against All Heresies, Book IX, The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
Leftow, Brian. “Anti Social Trinitarianism.” In The Trinity: An Interdisciplinary Symposium on the Trinity. Feenstra, R. J. and Plantinga, C. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1989.
Peters, Ted. God as Trinity. Louisville, KY: Westminster/John Knox Press, 1993.
Photios, Patriarch of Constantinople. On the Mystagogy of the Holy Spirit. Astoria, NY: Studion Publishers, Inc., 1983.
Rea, Michael C. “Relative Identity and the Doctrine of the Trinity.” In Philosophic Christi vol. 5, No. 2 (2003): 431-445.
Rusch, William G., ed. The Trinitarian Controversy. Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1980.
Stead, C. Divine Substance. Oxford: The Clarendon Press, 1977.
Studer, Basil. Trinity and Incarnation. Collegeville, MN: The Liturgical Press, 1993.
Swinburne, Richard. The Christian God. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Van Inwagen, Peter. “And yet there are not three Gods but one God.” In Philosophy and the Christian Faith, ed. T. V. Morris. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1988.
Yandell, K. E. “The most brutal and inexcusable error in counting?” Trinity and consistency. Religious Studies 30 (1994): 201-17.

Author Information

H.E. Baber
Email: baber@usd.edu
University of San Diego
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy