Submissions
Submitting an Article for Publication
The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy encourages philosophy professors with Ph.D.s from around the world to email a specific subject-area editor or the general editors with an offer to submit an article. Articles should have a length of 6,000 to 15,000 words except in special cases approved in advance by the general editors. Please consult our lists of the 100 most desired articles, our other desired articles by subject-area of philosophy, and article titles already reserved. Aside from our desired article topics, prospective authors may propose an article on any other traditional philosophy subject or person not currently in the IEP.
When contacting the editors about submitting an article, please indicate:
- your educational credentials and university affiliation,
- the provisional title of the proposed article, and
- a tentative (and realistic) date of completion; six months is typical, but it must be less than twelve.
If the editors approve your request to write an article, please consult the guidelines for authors for information on article format, style, and the licensing agreement. Authors should submit their documents in Word or, if they contain many technical symbols, in LaTeX format. Do not use the Word Equation Editor very frequently, as each use must be changed by hand to html or LaTeX by our formatter. Graphics and photos should be emailed as separate attachments in jpg or gif or png format.
How Publication Decisions Are Made
After an article is received, the initial acceptance decision will be made by the subject-area editor, with advice from referees, and will be based on the quality of the article, with special attention given to the accuracy of the coverage of the topic, fairness to alternative positions, and clarity for the intended audience of philosophy students and faculty who are not specialists in the field. Submitted articles are blind reviewed by academic specialists (see our statement of scholarly standards) and are subject to four possible decisions:
- acceptance in its current form with no revisions;
- acceptance contingent on some revisions;
- rejection with an invitation to revise and resubmit;
- rejection with no invitation to resubmit.
Most submitted articles require at least some revision in form or substance before acceptance. Initial acceptance decisions by the area editors are subject to final approval by the general editors. This includes both the article content and the title. You may wish to view our guidelines for referees. Accepted articles are still subject to copy editing changes.
The new article will be copyedited, formatted, and provisionally posted until approved by the author.
The purpose of the IEP is to publish articles about philosophical issues and individual philosophers that are of interest in the field of academic philosophy. We consider “philosophers” to be people whose positions have been criticized or defended within academic philosophy journals. As such, the IEP does not aim to be broad encyclopedia of public intellectuals, and, consequently, it excludes writers such as Mary Baker Eddy, Barack Obama, Leon Trotsky, and Joseph Smith, in spite of their intellectual contributions.
Revising Your Article after Publication
While the IEP currently does not require authors to update their articles on a fixed timetable, the general editors may request changes on an individual basis, and the authors themselves may wish to make revisions. Please see our guidelines for authors for information on how to revise posted articles.