Instructions for Referees

Thank you for agreeing to evaluate an article for The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy (IEP). All of our correspondence is through e-mail, and so we request that you submit your report via e-mail to the IEP editor who contacted you. You are a blind referee in the sense that the author will never be told your name. You can include your report either in the body of an e-mail message, or as an attachment. Your report should include one of the following recommendations:

1. acceptance in its current form with no revisions;
2. acceptance contingent on some revisions;
3. rejection with an invitation to revise and resubmit;
4. rejection with no invitation to resubmit.

Your recommendation should be justified by an analysis of the essay that describes its strengths and weaknesses and includes whatever comments or suggestions you believe would be helpful to the author. In most cases the report itself will be sent to the author just as you provide it (but without including your name or email address). Accordingly, please specify any remarks you make to the editors that should not be sent to the author. In considering your recommendation regarding publication in the IEP, please take note of our Statement of Purpose. First time referees should consult our Guidelines for Authoring Articles.

Regarding quotations and citations, these are less important for an encyclopedia article than a journal article, since the encyclopedia article is designed not to guide researchers in their research, but is designed more to expose a wide population of readers to the topic.

Thank you again for your help to the profession.

James Fieser (jfieser@utm.edu)
Bradley Dowden (dowden@csus.edu)