Al-Ghazālī (c. 1056–1111)

Al-Ghazālī did not regard himself as a philosopher, given that during his period in Islamic intellectual history, philosophy was associated with the Aristotelian tradition promulgated primarily by Avicenna (Ibn Sina), and, for al-Ghazālī, Avicenna was undoubtedly considered to be an unbeliever whose philosophical views (such as his commitment to the eternity of the world) fell outside the scope of orthodox Sunni Islam. There would be a serious stigma attached, from the perspective of Islamic orthodoxy, with al-Ghazālī identifying with the philosophers. Instead, al-Ghazālī regarded himself primarily as a Sufi (mystic), theologian, and jurist.

Yet despite his aversion to particular philosophical theses, it is clear that Al-Ghazālī is not only sympathetic to particular disciplines and methodologies of philosophy (for example, logic and ethics), but produces work that would certainly qualify as philosophical both in his day and ours. Indeed, he contributed immensely to the history of Islamic philosophy and the history of philosophy more generally, and he is considered to be one of the greatest and most influential thinkers in Islamic intellectual history. Al-Ghazālī’s philosophical work spans epistemology, metaphysics, philosophy of mind, natural philosophy, and ethics. His philosophical work had a wide-reaching influence within the Islamic world, and his Incoherence of the Philosophers, in particular, was well-received by other medieval philosophers and the Latin philosophical tradition.

Life and Works
Skepticism in the Deliverance from Error
Assessment of Philosophy
1. Materialists, Naturalists, and Theists
2. The Philosophical Sciences
Incoherence of the Philosophers
Revival of the Religious Sciences
Islamic Philosophy after Al-Ghazālī
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works

Al-Ghazālī, who holds the title of the “Proof of Islam,” was a Persian-Islamic jurist, mystic, theologian, and philosopher, born c.1058 in Tus, Khorasan (a region in the northeast of modern-day Iran, near Mashad). According to tradition, before his father died, he left the young al-Ghazālī and his brother Ahmad to the tutelage of an Islamic teacher and Sufi; he was eventually transferred to a local madrasa (Islamic school) after this teacher died where he continued his religious studies. After this early period of Islamic learning, al-Ghazālī received an advanced education in the Islamic sciences, particularly theology, from Imam al-Juwaynī (the leading Ash‘arite theologian of the day) in Nishapur.

An early experience that shaped the scholarly character of al-Ghazālī was when his caravan was raided during his travels. Al-Ghazālī demanded from the leader of the robbers that his notebooks and texts not be seized from him. When the robber asked al-Ghazālī what these writings were, Al-Ghazālī responded by saying “My writings contain all of the knowledge that I have acquired during my travels.” The leader then asked al-Ghazālī: “If you claim that you possess this knowledge, then how can I take it away from you?” Al-Ghazālī was deeply moved by this question, regarding this utterance of the robber as divine sent, and afterwards resolved to commit everything he studied to memory.

His reputation as a young scholar eventually led him to be appointed as a professor at the Nizamiyya College in Baghdad in 1091 by Niẓām al-Mulk. Although al-Ghazālī was highly successful as a professor, accruing a large following of students (he claims at one point that he had 300 students), during the period of his professorship it seems that he grew skeptical of his intentions with respect to teaching. That is, he questioned whether his professional ambitions were truly for the sake of God or personal aggrandizement, and he ultimately underwent a skeptical and spiritual crisis (this crisis is distinct from the skeptical crisis discussed in section 2). As he describes it, this crisis had psychosomatic effects, preventing him from speaking and thereby teaching his classes. Resolved to purify his intentions and recover an authentic experience of Islam, al-Ghazālī left his post and his family in Baghdad in 1095 to travel for ten years pursuing and cultivating the Sufi or mystical way of life. He visited Damascus, Jerusalem, and Hebron; and made a pilgrimage to Mecca and Medina. During this time, he writes that:

My only occupation was seclusion and solitude and spiritual exercise and combat with a view to devoting myself to the purification of my soul and the cultivation of virtues and cleansing my heart for the remembrance of God Most High, in the way I had learned from the writings of the sufis. (Deliverance: 80)

Al-Ghazālī eventually returned to teaching in Nishapur (Northeast Iran), seemingly motivated to rid the masses of theological, spiritual, and philosophical confusions, and convinced by his colleagues that he could help revive the true theory and practice of Islam. However, he eventually retired to Tus, where he established a Sufi school, and lived a quiet life of scholarly work and meditation. He died in 1111 at the age of 55 in Tus.

Al-Ghazālī is regarded as one of the most important intellectuals in all of Islamic history. He is most well-known for his work Revival of the Religious Sciences, a work divided into forty books which covers creed, theology, mysticism, ethics, and jurisprudence. Al-Ghazālī’s philosophical and theological work emerges in texts such as Deliverance from Error, Incoherence of the Philosophers, and Niche of Lights.

2. Skepticism in the Deliverance from Error

Written in the style of a spiritual and intellectual autobiography (Menn 2003), Deliverance from Error is one of al-Ghazālī’s most well-known texts. The Deliverance from Error covers a number of topics, from the errors of the Islamic philosophers (in particular, al-Farabi and Avicenna), the nature of prophecy, to the truth of Sufism. However, it has attracted the attention of historians of philosophy, especially for its engagement with skepticism in the first part of the text. This section discusses al-Ghazālī’s skeptical arguments, his solution to skepticism, and the popular question of the similarities between al-Ghazālī’s skepticism and that of Descartes’.

a. Motivations

Before introducing his skeptical arguments, al-Ghazālī first provides some motivations for engaging skepticism, then he provides a theory of knowledge that provides the grounds for a strategy to determine whether a subject’s belief in a proposition amounts to knowledge. Al-Ghazālī claims that from a young age, he had a strong desire to seek knowledge: “The thirst for grasping the real meaning of things was indeed my habit and wont from my early years and in the prime of my life” (Deliverance: 54). However, the following observation raised a nagging doubt for him as to whether this desire would lead him to objective knowledge:

The children of Christians always grew up embracing Christianity, and the children of Jews grew up adhering to Judaism, and the children of Muslims always grew up following the religion of Islam. (Ibid. 55)

The worry that al-Ghazālī has is that what we take to be knowledge (for example, a religious claim to truth) might be due more to parental or societal conditioning (blind imitation or taqlīd), rather than being due to objective epistemic standards. This led al-Ghazālī to inquire into the true nature of knowledge. So, what then are the objective standards for knowledge? al-Ghazālī writes:

Sure and certain knowledge is that in which the thing known is made so manifest that no doubt clings to it, nor is it accompanied by the possibility of error and deception. (Ibid.)

Al-Ghazālī’s account of knowledge here has received sophisticated treatment in the literature (See Albertini 2005; Hadisi 2022). It is also important to note that this is not the only type of knowledge that al-Ghazālī recognizes. For example, later in Deliverance from Error al-Ghazālī will identify other types of knowledge, such as dhawq or fruitful experience (a type of knowledge-by-acquaintance—see Götz 2003).

However, an operative definition of Ghazālīan knowledge, at least as it is used in this part of the Deliverance from Error, is the following: A subject, S, knows that p if and only if: (1) S believes that p, (2) p is true, and (3) p is absolutely certain. Certainty is the key criterion here, as for al-Ghazālī there can be no room for doubt in a genuine item of knowledge. (For an in-depth analysis of al-Ghazālī’s conception of absolute certainty see Hadisi 2022).

With this definition of knowledge in hand, al-Ghazālī now devises a strategy for determining whether his beliefs—particularly sensory beliefs and rational beliefs—amount to knowledge. If any proposition or belief lacks certainty (that is, is dubitable) then it cannot count as knowledge: “Whatever I did not know in this way and was not certain of with this kind of certainty was unreliable and unsure knowledge” (See also Book of Knowledge: 216). Al-Ghazālī then turns to his sensory and rational beliefs to see if they can meet his standard for knowledge.

b. Sensory Perception Doubt and Dream Doubt

With this theory of knowledge and strategy for examining his beliefs in place, al-Ghazālī raises two separate skeptical arguments that generate his skepticism: a sensory perception doubt, which targets the reliability of sense data; and a dream doubt, which targets the reliability of the primary truths of the intellect.

The sensory perception doubt runs as follows:

The strongest of the senses is the sense of sight. Now this looks at a shadow and sees it standing still and motionless and judges that motion must be denied. Then, due to experience and observation an hour later it knows that the shadow is moving, and that did not move in a sudden spurt, but so gradually and imperceptibly that it was never completely at rest. (Deliverance: 56)

Here is a plausible reconstruction of the argument:

1. If the senses misrepresent the properties of external objects, then sense data cannot be a source of knowledge about the external world.
2. The senses misrepresent the properties of external objects
3. Therefore, sense data cannot be a source of knowledge about the external world.

After having engaged the sensory perception doubt, al-Ghazālī admits that his sensory beliefs cannot amount to knowledge. Instead, he proposes that his rational beliefs, particularly his beliefs in primary truths are still secure. For al-Ghazālī, primary truths are necessary truths which are foundational to proofs, such as the law of non-contradiction: “One and the same thing cannot be simultaneously affirmed and denied” (Deliverance: 56). However, against his reliance on primary truths, al-Ghazālī raises the dream doubt, which runs as follows:

Don’t you see that when you are asleep you believe certain things and imagine certain circumstances and believe they are fixed and lasting and entertain no doubts about that being their status? Then you wake up and know that all your imaginings and beliefs were groundless and unsubstantial. So while everything you believe through sensation or intellection in your waking state may be true in relation to that state, what assurance have you that you may not suddenly experience a state which would have the same relation to your waking state as the latter has to your dreaming, and your waking state would be dreaming in relation to that new and further state? If you found yourself in such a state, you would be sure that all your rational beliefs were unsubstantial fancies. (Ibid. 57)

Here is a plausible reconstruction of the argument:

1. In our current cognitive position, we cannot doubt primary truths.
2. However, if our current cognitive position may be akin to a dream state where what we perceive is false, then what we take to be primary truths cannot be a source of knowledge.
3. We cannot rule out the possibility that our current cognitive position is akin to such a dream state.
4. It is possible that we can wake up from this dream state into a new and higher cognitive position where we realize that the primary truths, we held to be necessarily true are actually false.
5. Therefore, our belief in primary truths in our current cognitive position cannot amount to knowledge.

After having raised the dream doubt, al-Ghazālī finds himself in a skeptical crisis (It is important to note that these two doubts do not generate a hyperbolic doubt, under which every proposition is considered dubious. This is evidenced by the fact that al-Ghazālī does not rule out the existence of God during his skeptical crisis. He writes that he attempted to refute the dream doubt, however, his:

Effort was unsuccessful, since the objections could be refuted only by proof. But the only way to put together a proof was to combine primary cognitions. So if, in my case, these were inadmissible, it was impossible to construct the proof. (Ibid.)

The skeptical challenge al-Ghazālī has raised is particularly pernicious. In order to, refute either skeptical doubt al-Ghazālī would have to put together proof. However, proofs require primary truths, which are now suspect. As such, al-Ghazālī has his hands tied, as it were, for he cannot construct a proof. Consequently, there is no way for al-Ghazālī himself to defeat skepticism.

c. Resolution of Skepticism

Al-Ghazālī claims that his skepticism lasted for two months, during which time he was a skeptic. However, he claims that he eventually overcame his skepticism. But he did not defeat skepticism through any proof; rather, it came about through God’s intervention via a divine light:

At length God Most High cured me of that sickness. My soul regained its health and equilibrium and once again I accepted the self-evident data of reason and relied on them with safety and certainty. But that was not achieved by constructing a proof or putting together an argument. On the contrary, it was the effect of a light which God Most High cast into my breast. And that light is the key to most knowledge. (Ibid.)

Commentators generally understand al-Ghazālī as having an experience of dhawq via the divine light, which is supposed to secure the foundations of his knowledge. In the Niche of Lights, al-Ghazālī explains that the function of a light is to reveal the existence of something, and a divine light in particular reveals the true nature of that thing and is the source of certainty (Hesova 2012; Loumia 2020). On Hadisi’s (2022), reading it is through the engagement of Sufi practices that cultivate the imagination that makes this experience of the divine light possible. While there is much scholarly debate about the nature of this divine light and the conditions for its experience, it is argued that (unlike Descartes) al-Ghazālī clearly does not defeat skepticism through any rational efforts of his own. Rather he is rescued from skepticism through a divine intervention.

d. Al-Ghazālī and Descartes

On the face of it, there are a lot of similarities between al-Ghazālī Deliverance from Error and Descartes’ Discourse on Method (1637) and Meditations on First Philosophy (1641), both of which were written 500 years after the Deliverance from Error. As such, many modern commentators have been interested in studying the relationship between Descartes and al-Ghazālī (See Albertini 2005; Azadpur 2003; Götz 2003; Moad 2009). Commentators have debated two issues on this score: what the exact similarities are between al-Ghazālī and Descartes’ engagement with skepticism, and whether there is historical evidence that al-Ghazālī had any real influence on Descartes.

Commentators generally agree that there are similarities between the two philosophers’ search for certainty and, in particular, the skeptical arguments they raise. In 1857, George Henry Lewes wrote that the Deliverance from Error: “bears so remarkable a resemblance to the Discours sur la Méthode of Descartes, that had any translation of it existed in the days of Descartes, everyone would have cried out against the plagiarism” (1970: 306). For starters, both al-Ghazālī and Descartes place absolute certainty at the center of their epistemology and develop a similar strategy for evaluating whether their beliefs amount to knowledge, that is, a belief that is dubitable in any respect cannot amount to true knowledge. Furthermore, both al-Ghazālī and Descartes employ a sensory perception doubt and a dream doubt. However, while the sensory perception doubt for both philosophers’ functions similarly, the dream doubt does not. Recall, that al-Ghazālī uses the dream doubt to target the reliability of intellectual beliefs or primary truths. However, in the Meditations on First Philosophy Descartes uses the dream doubt to question the existence of the external world. Descartes uses a separate doubt, what is often called the defective nature doubt, to question the reliability of the intellect and intellectual beliefs. Moreover, while al-Ghazālī’s skeptical arguments do not generate hyperbolic doubt (because he never questions the existence of God), Descartes’ skepticism does end up in global skepticism. There also seems to be a difference in how the philosophers defeat skepticism. As it is well-known, Descartes ultimately claims to defeat skepticism through the natural light of reason. However, al-Ghazālī requires supernatural assistance through the divine light and explicitly denies that he can defeat skepticism through the use of reason and rational proofs.

As for whether Descartes had access to al-Ghazālī’s works, there is a theory that there was a translation of the Deliverance from Error in Latin that Descartes had access to; however, this theory is unlikely. Indeed, the Deliverance from Error was not translated until 1842, when it was translated into French (Van Ess 2018). There is also the possibility that the Deliverance from Error was orally translated for Descartes by Golius, an orientalist who had access to the Arabic Deliverance from Error (Götz 2003). However, there is only circumstantial evidence for this claim. In the end, the best evidence for there being an influence seems to be the striking similarities between al-Ghazālī and Descartes’ engagement with skepticism.

3. Assessment of Philosophy

a. Materialists, Naturalists, and Theists

After having defeated skepticism, al-Ghazālī proceeds to examine the “various categories of those seeking the truth,” to determine whether he can gain anything from them in his newfound path to knowledge, and in particular, whether these categories of seekers conform with the truth on religious matters according to orthodox Islam, or in a state of unbelief (kufr). Regarding his study of philosophy, al-Ghazālī claims that he studied and reflected on philosophy independently (without a teacher) for just under three years. He claims: “God Most High gave me an insight into the farthest reaches of the philosophers’ sciences in less than two years,” and he reflected “assiduously on it for nearly a year” until he understood philosophy’s “precision and delusion” (Deliverance: 61).

The philosophers, al-Ghazālī claims, are those “who maintain that they are the men of logic and apodeictic demonstration” (Ibid. 58) and he divides them into three groups: materialists, naturalists, and theists. Regarding the materialists, al-Ghazālī writes that these were ancient philosophers who denied the existence of an omniscient and omnipotent “Creator-Ruler.” Their fundamental claim is that the world is eternal, and it exists without a creator. According to al-Ghazālī, these philosophers are “the godless in the full sense of the term” (Ibid. 61).

Regarding the naturalists, al-Ghazālī writes that these were the ancient philosophers who devoted themselves to the study of “nature and the marvels found in animals and plants” (Ibid. 62). Unlike the materialists, these philosophers found God’s wisdom in the creation of the universe. What was problematic about these philosophers, is that they denied the immortality of the soul, claiming that the soul ceased to exist upon the corruption of its humors, and thus it would be impossible to bring back a non-existent soul. As such these philosophers denied the afterlife, despite believing in God and his attributes. These philosophers were not thoroughly godless in the way that the materialists were, but still held problematic beliefs that are objectionable from the perspective of orthodox Islam. These are unbelievers as well.

Regarding the theists, al-Ghazālī writes that these were the later ancient philosophers, such as Socrates, Plato, and Aristotle who admitted a Creator-Ruler in their philosophical systems. These philosophers, according to al-Ghazālī, refuted the materialists and naturalists and also refined the philosophical sciences. Nonetheless, all of these philosophers and their transmitters among the Islamic philosophers (that is, al-Farabi and Ibn Sina) must be charged with unbelief due to their still subscribing to theses such as the eternity of the world.

b. The Philosophical Sciences

Al-Ghazālī divides the sciences of philosophy into six fields: mathematics, logic, physical science, metaphysics, political philosophy, and moral philosophy or ethics (In the Book of Knowledge, he divides them into four: mathematics, logic, physical science, and metaphysics). Here, we will discuss his approach to mathematics, logic, physical science, political philosophy, and ethics, reserving his views on metaphysics for section 4 on the “Incoherence of the Philosophers.”

One might think that since al-Ghazālī wrote the Incoherence of the Philosophers, and claims that the ancient philosophers al-Farabi and Avicenna are unbelievers, he is completely antithetical to philosophy. However, it is important to note that the title of his famous text is not the Incoherence of Philosophy. Rather, al-Ghazālī, in general, takes specific issues with certain philosophical theses, rather than with the discipline of philosophy itself. Nonetheless, there are ways in which he thinks that an improper engagement with philosophy can lead to certain evils.

Regarding mathematics, which concerns arithmetic, geometry, and astronomy, he claims that: “nothing in them entails denial or affirmation of religious matters” (Deliverance: 63); rather, they contain facts which cannot be denied. Nonetheless, he identifies two evils that can follow from an improper engagement with mathematics.

The first evil occurs when a person who studies mathematics assumes that since philosophers have precision in their mathematical proofs, such precision in arriving at the truth extends to other areas of philosophy, such as metaphysics. This will make them susceptible to believing false metaphysical positions that are not actually demonstrated according to al-Ghazālī. Furthermore, this makes the person susceptible to unbelief because they will conform to the philosophers’ disdain (in al-Ghazālī’s view) for the law and religion more generally.

The second evil comes from the champion of Islam who believes that everything in philosophy must be rejected. When another person hears of such negative claims about philosophy as a whole, this will lead to them having a low opinion of Islam, for it seems that Islam is incompatible with clear mathematical truths established by demonstration, so “he becomes all the more enamored with philosophy and envenomed against Islam” (Ibid. 64).

Similarly, al-Ghazālī claims that logic does not conflict with religion, for it only concerns proofs, syllogisms, the conditions of demonstration, and the requisites for sound definitions. He admits that the philosophers have a greater refinement in their study and use of logic, which exceeds that of the theologians. Nonetheless, two evils can come from an improper understanding of the philosophers’ use of logic. First, if logic is rejected by the believer, this will lead the philosophers to have a low opinion of this rejector, and their religion more generally. Second, if the student of logic has too high opinion of the philosophers’ use of logic, they may come to believe that their metaphysical theses that amount to unbelief must be actually backed by demonstration, before even coming to examine the metaphysics per se.

The physical sciences or natural philosophy, which concerns the study of the heavens, stars, the sublunar world, and composite bodies, are also not objectionable with respect to religion, except for certain issues that al-Ghazālī covers in the Incoherence of the Philosophers. Al-Ghazālī stresses that one must remember that every aspect of physics is “totally subject to God Most High: it does not act of itself but is used as an instrument by its Creator” (Deliverance: 66) Any physical science whose theory rests on a denial of the dependency of an aspect of the physical world on the divine is objectionable (see section== 4d for al-Ghazālī’s views on causation and occasionalism).

Regarding political philosophy, al-Ghazālī does not regard the philosophers as contributing anything novel, for they “simply took these over from the scriptures revealed to the prophets” (Ibid. 67). As such, it seems that al-Ghazālī does not find issues with the philosophers’ views on political philosophy.

In al-Ghazālī’s view, ethics concerns “the qualities and habits of the soul, and recording their generic and specific kinds, and the way to cultivate the good ones and combat the bad” (Ibid.). According to al-Ghazālī, the philosophers’ ethical views derive from the sayings of the Sufis and prophets, and thus in general their ethical views are not objectionable (Kukkonen 2016; cf. Quasem 1974). Nonetheless, there are two evils that can arise from an improper engagement with philosophical ethics.

First, there is an evil that arises for the person who rejects philosophical ethics because they subscribe to a wholesale rejection of philosophy, due to their knowledge of other errors of the philosophers (for example, in metaphysics). This is problematic because, for example, the utterances of the prophets are true and should not be rejected. The fundamental problem here, according to al-Ghazālī, is that this “dim-witted” person does not know how to evaluate the truth: “The intelligent man, therefore, first knows the truth, then he considers what is actually said by someone. If it is true, he accepts it, whether the speaker be wrong or right in other matters” (Ibid. 68). Second, there is the evil that arises for the person who accepts philosophical ethics wholesale. The evil here is that one will slip into accepting the metaphysical errors of the philosophers that are mixed in with their ethical teachings.

4. Incoherence of the Philosophers

In the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī famously condemns al-Farabi and Avicenna as unbelievers for their philosophical views. The notion of unbelief has come up thus far in this article, but what does it mean to be an unbeliever from the Islamic perspective? Al-Ghazālī defines unbelief or kufr as follows: “‘unbelief’ is to deem anything the Prophet brought to be a lie” (On the Boundaries of Theological Tolerance: 92). Unbelief is contrasted with its opposite, faith or iman: “‘faith’ is to deem everything he brought to be true” (Ibid.). From this basic definition, it follows:

Every Unbeliever deems one or more of the prophets to be a liar. And everyone who deems one or more of the prophets to be a liar is an Unbeliever. This is the criterion that should be applied evenly across the board. (Ibid. 93)

According to al-Ghazālī, the so-called “Islamic philosophers” ascribe to philosophical theses that are fundamentally incompatible with the religion of Islam, that is, these theses imply that the Prophet Muhammad, in particular, is a liar, and thus puts them outside the fold of orthodoxy. Out of the twenty theses he identifies, three in particular conflict fundamentally with Islam: (1) belief in the eternity of the world, (2) belief that God can only know universals and not particulars, and (3) denial of the bodily resurrection. The other seventeen are innovations and are thus heterodox positions from the perspective of orthodox Islam. They do not, strictly speaking, constitute unbelief and thus one could still technically remain a Muslim while believing one of these innovations. But according to al-Ghazālī, the other three doctrines:

Do not agree with Islam in any respect. The one who believes them believes that prophets utter falsehoods and that they said whatever they have said by way of [promoting common] utility, to give examples and explanation to the multitudes of created mankind. This is manifest infidelity which none of the Islamic sects have believed. (Incoherence: 226)

In addition to holding heretical beliefs, al-Ghazālī claims that the philosophers are heretics in practice as well, for they:

Have rejected the Islamic duties regarding acts of worship, disdained religious rites pertaining to the offices of prayer and the avoidance of prohibited things, belittled the devotions and ordained prescribed by the divine law, not halting in the face of its prohibitions and restrictions. (Ibid. 1-2).

With respect to their philosophical views, however, al-Ghazālī does not view the Islamic philosophers as original. In his view, al-Farabi and Ibn Sina do not produce anything philosophically novel, rather they merely regurgitate and reproduce ancient Greek philosophical views. As he, writes: “There is no basis for their unbelief other than traditional, conventional imitation” (Ibid. 2; for more on the philosophers’ imitation or taqlid see Griffel 2005). The charge of unbelief or apostasy against al-Farabi and Avicenna has severe implications, in particular, it allows for them to be killed. As Frank Griffel makes explicit, for al-Ghazālī, “Whoever publicly supports or teaches the three named positions indeed deserves to be killed” (2007: 103).

Al-Ghazālī employs a unique strategy in revealing the philosophers’ “incoherence,” which is that he wants to beat the philosophers at their own game. The philosophers claim to establish their theses based on valid demonstrations with true and certain premises. However, al-Ghazālī aims to show that their demonstrations actually do not meet their own standards for truth, certainty, and validity:

There is neither firm foundation nor perfection in the doctrine they hold; that they judge in terms of supposition and surmise, without verification or certainty; that they use the appearance of their mathematical and logical sciences as evidential proof for the truth of their metaphysical sciences, using [this] as a gradual enticement for the weak in mind. (Incoherence: 4)

While al-Ghazālī does use scripture as a motivation for his own views, his objections to the philosophers do not amount to merely citing scripture that conflicts with a philosophical thesis. Rather, he raises philosophical objections against them with the aim of showing that their views imply problematic consequences, which they should concede given their own logical standards and epistemic position:

I do not enter into [argument] objecting to them, except as one who demands and denies, not as one who claims [and] affirms. I will render murky what they believe in [by showing] conclusively that they must hold to various consequences [of their theories]. (Ibid. 7)

It is important to note that for each Discussion in the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī considers a variety of proofs for the philosophers’ views, and correspondingly raises many objections against them. Here, we will only consider a portion of these arguments.

a. The Eternity of the World

In the First Discussion of the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī considers four distinct proofs for the eternity of the world. The thesis of the eternity of the world is objectionable within orthodox Islam, according to al-Ghazālī, because scripture is clear that the world was created ex nihilo. For example, there is a verse in the Qur’an that states: “All it takes, when He wills something is simply to say to it: “Be!” And it is!” (36: 82). What this verse essentially implies is that God can create an existent out of nothing. Of course, this serves as a motivation to refute the philosophers’ proofs for the eternity of the world but does not constitute a refutation on its own, as al-Ghazālī wants to show that the philosophers’ own demonstrations fail.

Let us consider the first proof for the eternity of the world, which he claims is the philosophers’ strongest and most imaginative one. The first proof depends on the fundamental concepts of will and causality (Hourani 1958). Every change (whether physical or mental) requires some cause. For example, a billiard ball is moved by a billiard stick, and the perception of a bear can raise the emotion of fear in a subject. Thus, if God wills some new state of affairs, this must occur due to some cause external to God. Let us suppose, then, that the world was created ex nihilo at the beginning of time, and is not eternal. If God created the world in this way, then something must have influenced his constant, eternal, and unmoved nature to influence his will to arrive at this volition. But we are supposing that nothing exists besides God. If so, then there is nothing outside of God’s will to have such an influence on Him, because there are no causes that exist external to God. This would seem to imply that the world could never exist and that God exists alone eternally without anything else existing alongside Him. But we know that the world does exist. The only option that follows is that the world has existed eternally, as an eternal emanation from the divine essence.

Al-Ghazālī responds by arguing that God’s will can, as it were, postdate the existence of the world so that the world comes into existence at a designated point in time. As such, the world would not have to be eternal. The philosophers (on al-Ghazālī’s reconstruction) would answer to this as follows:

It is impossible for that which necessitates [a thing] to exist with all the conditions of its being necessitating, [all the conditions] of its principles and causes fulfilled, such that nothing at all remains awaited, and then for the necessitated [effect] to be delayed. (Incoherence: 15)

In other words, postdating the existence of the world is impossible because if God has the will for the world to exist, then this volition must have existed eternally. Unless there is an obstacle to delay God’s will from coming to fruition, then there should be no delay in the creation of the world since all the conditions for the world to exist have been met. Thus, the world must be eternal.

Al-Ghazālī objects that the philosophers do not truly know that it is impossible for God’s will to postdate the existence of the world:

It is incumbent on you to set up a demonstrative proof according to the condition of logic that would show the impossibility of this. For, in all of what you have stated, there is nothing but [an expression of] unlikelihood and the drawing of an analogy with our resolve and will, this being false, since the eternal will does not resemble temporal [human] intentions. As regards the sheer deeming of something as unlikely, without demonstrative proof, [this] is not sufficient. (Ibid. 17)

The philosophers claim that a finite and temporal world being created by an eternal will is impossible, but they have not shown the contradiction in God’s will postdating the existence of the world, even without there being an obstacle to his will creating the world earlier. All they have done is provide an analogy between human will and divine will, which is not sufficient for proof.

b. God’s Knowledge: Universals vs. Particulars

In the Thirteenth Discussion of the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī aims to refute the philosophers’ claim that God only knows universals, but not particulars. This is objectionable within Islam because the Qur’an claims that: “Not an atom’s weight is hidden from Him in the heavens or the earth” (34: 3). According to al-Ghazālī, scripture is clear that God’s knowledge is infinite and all-encompassing, extending to everything that exists and everything that is possible (Moderation in Belief: 104). Again, scripture serves as a motivation for refuting the philosophers on this score, but al-Ghazālī will provide independent objections against their demonstrations.

According to Avicenna, God does not have knowledge of particulars per se, rather, He has knowledge of particulars in a universal manner. This is an implication of Avicenna’s conception of God or the necessary being (Belo 2006). According to Avicenna, God is an intellect that consists of pure thought and activity and is a being wholly distinct from matter and extension. Insofar as God’s essence is thought, this implies that God’s essence is identical with knowledge, since any type of thought that does not qualify as knowledge is not fitting to the perfection of God. Furthermore, the perfection of God’s knowledge requires that God himself is the first object of his knowledge, a reflective act which requires an identity between subject and object of knowledge.

Insofar as God is wholly distinct from matter, this implies that God’s knowledge does not depend on matter or sensory perception in any way, as it does for human beings. As such, God cannot have knowledge of particulars (at least in the way that humans do) because he is not subject to the same physical and temporal processes involved in being a human being, and sensory perception more generally. The example discussed here by Avicenna and al-Ghazālī is that of an eclipse (Belo 2006). We can divide the knowledge an astronomer has of an eclipse into three stages. First, before an eclipse occurs, an astronomer will know that an eclipse is not occurring but will be expecting it. Second, when the eclipse occurs, the astronomer will know that it is occurring. Second, when the eclipse ends, the astronomer will know that the eclipse is a past event. With each stage of the eclipse, there is a corresponding change in the knowledge of the astronomer, and thus a change in the astronomer himself. But this is problematic with respect to God’s knowledge of the eclipse. As al-Ghazālī formulates Avicenna’s view, the claim is that:

If the object known changes, knowledge changes; and if knowledge changes, the knower inescapably changes. But change in God is impossible. (Incoherence: 135)

Since knowing particulars per se would make God subject to change, Avicenna instead maintains that God has knowledge of particulars in a universal manner. This holds in three senses (Belo 2006): First, God’s knowledge is universal in the sense that it is intellectual, and not sensory in any way. Second, God’s knowledge is universal in the sense that his knowledge precedes the objects of his knowledge because he is the cause of their existence. Third, God’s knowledge of particulars extends only to their general qualities. Al-Ghazālī finds this view entirely objectionable from the perspective of orthodox Islam:

This is a principle which they believed and through which they uprooted religious laws in their entirety, since it entails that if Zayd, for example, obeys or disobeys God, God would not know what of his states has newly come about, because He does not know Zayd in his particularity. (Ibid. 136)

Al-Ghazālī agrees that God’s essence cannot admit change, but claims that Avicenna’s analysis of the eclipse example rests on confusion. The essence of Avicenna’s argument, in al-Ghazālī’s view, is that God would undergo change if he knew the particulars of an eclipse because he would move from a state of ignorance to a state of knowledge about the eclipse (in the transition from stages one to two), which would constitute a change in God’s essence. Al-Ghazālī objects that Gods’ knowledge is singular throughout the process of the changes in the eclipse. That is, God’s knowledge of the eclipse before it exists when it exists, and after it exists are all the same knowledge. In al-Ghazālī’s opinion, the differences in the states of the eclipse are relational—that is, in the way God relates to the changes in the eclipse—and thus does not require change in the intrinsic knowledge or the essence of the knower (God).

c. Bodily Resurrection

In the Twentieth Discussion of the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī aims to refute the philosophers’ denial of bodily resurrection. The philosophers maintain that the soul is immortal, but deny a bodily resurrection in the afterlife. For al-Ghazālī, this is in clear contradiction with scripture and religious law as well. Al-Ghazālī reconstructs three different ways one might conceive of bodily resurrection, how the philosophers would respond to each type of resurrection, and he provides his analysis of each type of resurrection.

First, one might view the resurrection as “God’s returning the annihilated body back to existence and the returning of the life which had been annihilated” (Incoherence: 216). In this view, both the body and the soul are annihilated upon death, and newly created upon resurrection. The philosophers argue that this view of resurrection is false because the human being that is resurrected will not be identical to the original human being, but merely similar to the original human being. This is because there is not something that continues to exist between the annihilation of the body and the soul, and the human being’s “resurrection,” for “unless there is something that [continues to] exist, there [also] being numerically two things that are similar [but] separated by time, then [the meaning of] the term ‘return’ is not fulfilled” (Incoherence: 216). Al-Ghazālī responds by conceding with the philosophers that this option does not amount to a resurrection:

For the human is a human not by virtue of his matter and the earth that is in him, since all or most of [his] parts are changed for him through nourishment while he remains that very same individual. For he is what he is by virtue of his spirit or soul. If, then, life or spirit ceases to exist, then the return of what ceases to exist is unintelligible. (Ibid. 216)

Second, one might view the resurrection as occurring when “the soul exists and survives death but that the first body is changed back [into existence] with all its very parts” (Ibid. 215). The philosophers argue that if this option were conceivable, it would constitute a resurrection. However, they argue that this option is impossible. The philosophers raise several objections here. One of them appeals to cannibalism:

If a human eats the flesh of another human, which is customary in some lands and becomes frequent in times of famine, the [bodily] resurrection of both together becomes impossible because one substance was the body of the individual eaten and has become, through eating, [part of] the body of the eater. And it is impossible to return two souls to the same body. (Ibid. 217)

In short, the philosophers claim that it is impossible to resurrect the body with its original matter.

Third, one might view the resurrection as occurring when the soul is returned to a body, regardless of whether that body is constituted by its original matter for: “The [person] resurrected would be that [identical] human inasmuch as the soul would be that [same] soul” (Ibid. 215). The philosophers argue that this option does not work either because the individual resurrected “would not be a human unless the parts of his body divide into flesh, bone, and [the four] humors” (Ibid. 218) In other words, the philosophers claim that the raw materials of the earth, for example, wood and iron, are not sufficient to reconstitute a body: “it is impossible to return the human and his body [to life] from wood or iron” (Ibid.).

Al-Ghazālī’s response to the philosophers’ dismissal of the second and third types of resurrection is to argue that the body does not matter at all in the identity of the individual resurrected. Rather, it is the continuity of the soul that matters:

This is possible by returning [the soul] to the body, whatever body this might be, whether [composed] of the matter of the first body [or from that] of another or from matter whose creation commences anew. For [an individual] is what he is by virtue of his soul, not his body, since the parts of the body change over for him from childhood to old age through being emaciated, becoming fat, and [undergoing] change of nourishment. His temperament changes with [all] this, while yet remaining that very same human. (Ibid. 219)

According to al-Ghazālī, during the life of a particular human being, the body will undergo a variety of changes while the person remains the same, due to the continued existence of their soul. In the same way, it does not matter from which materials the body is reconstituted when the human being is resurrected, for if the same soul exists in the afterlife as it did in the previous life in the new body, then the individual is the same.

d. Causation and Occasionalism

In the Seventeenth Discussion of the Incoherence of the Philosophers, al-Ghazālī aims to refute the philosophers’ claim that there is a necessary condition between cause and effect. This view is problematic with respect to Islam because it conflicts with the existence of miracles, and God’s ability to change the course of nature at will. This is technically one of the innovative theses of the philosophers.

According to Avicenna’s conception of (efficient) causation, there is a necessary connection between cause and effect (the necessitation thesis—see Richardson 2020). Avicenna’s argument for the necessitation thesis is in part based on his modal metaphysics of the necessary and the possible or contingent. Avicenna distinguishes between the necessary and the possible as follows: “That which in itself is a necessary existence has no cause, while that which in itself is a possible existent has a cause” (Metaphysics of the Healing I, 6: 30).According to Avicenna, the only necessary being is God because existence is a part of the essential nature of God. There is nothing external to God, a cause, that brings God into existence. All other beings, however, are merely possible in themselves because existence is not a part of their essence. Because they are possible, something external to them, a cause, is required to bring them into existence, otherwise they would not exist. As such, there must be an external cause that necessitates the existence of possible things. As Avicenna explains it in his discussion of ontological priority in the Metaphysics of the Healing:

The existence of the second is from the first, so that it [derives] from the first the necessary existence which is neither from nor in itself, having in itself only possibility—allowing [that is] that the first is such that, as long s it exists, it follows as a necessary consequence of its existence that it is the cause of the necessary existence of the second—then the first is prior in existence to the second. (Metaphysics of the Healing IV, 1: 126)

Al-Ghazālī rejects the necessitation theses:

The connection between what is habitually believed to be a cause and what is habitually believed to be an effect is not necessary, according to us. But [with] any two things, where “this” is not “that” and “that” is not “this” and where neither the affirmation of the one entails the affirmation of the other nor the negation of the one entails negation of the other, it is not a necessity of the existence of the one that the other should exist, and it is not a necessity of the nonexistence of the one that the other should not exist—for example, the quenching of thirst and drinking, satiety and eating, burning and contact with fire, light and the appearance of the sun, death and decapitation, healing and the drinking of medicine, the purging of the bowels and the using of a purgative, and so on to (include] all [that is] observable among connected things in medicine, astronomy, arts, and crafts. Their connection is due to the prior decree of God, who creates them side by side, not to its being necessary in itself, incapable of separation. On the contrary, it is within [divine] power to create satiety without eating, to create death without decapitation, to continue life after decapitation, and so on to all connected things. The philosophers denied the possibility of [this] and claimed it to be impossible. (Incoherence: 166)

According to al-Ghazālī, there is no necessary connection between cause and effect, because one can affirm the existence of the cause, without having to affirm the existence of the effect, and one can deny the existence of the cause, without having to deny the existence of the effect.

Consider the example of the burning of cotton when it comes in contact with fire. According to the philosophers, there is a necessary connection between the fire and the burning of the cotton. The fire is the cause or agent of change, that necessitates the effect of change of burning. Denying this causal relation would result in a contradiction. According to al-Ghazālī, however, the connection between fire and burning is not one of necessity; rather, God has created these two events concomitantly or side by side. And due to our repeated or habitual perceiving of these events occurring side by side, this makes us believe that there is a genuine causal relation:

But the continuous habit of their occurrence repeatedly, one time after another, fixes unshakably in our minds the belief in their occurrence according to past habit. (Ibid. 170)

Here, al-Ghazālī anticipates Hume’s theory of causation, according to which causation is nothing more than a constant conjunction between two events (On the differences between Hume and al-Ghazālī, see Moad 2008).

On the standard reading, al-Ghazālī ascribes to occasionalism, according to which creatures do not have any causal power; rather, God is the sole source of causal power in the world (Moad 2005). As al-Ghazālī writes:

The one who enacts the burning by creating blackness in the cotton, [causing] separation in its parts, and making it cinder or ashes is God, either through the mediation of His angels or without mediation. As for fire, which is inanimate, it has no action. (Incoherence: 167)

On behalf of the philosophers, al-Ghazālī raise a unique objection against his theory of causality, namely, that it entails a type of radical skepticism (Dutton 2001). If one denies the necessary connection between cause and effect, then one cannot know what events God—through his unrestrained freedom—will create as conjoined side by side:

If someone leaves a book in the house, let him allow as possible its change on his returning home into a beardless slave boy—intelligent, busy with his tasks—or into an animal; or if he leaves a boy in his house, let him allow the possibility of his changing into a dog; or [again] if he leaves ashes, [let him allow] the possibility of its change into musk; and let him allow the possibility of stone changing into gold and gold into stone. (Ibid. 170)

As Blake Dutton formulates it, the radical skepticism of al-Ghazālī’s theory of causality runs as follows:

Given that we must rely on causal inferences for our knowledge of the world and our ability to navigate our way through it, Ghazali’s position entails that we must face the world with no expectations and adopt a position of skeptical uncertainty. (Dutton 2001: 39)

Al-Ghazālī’s response is to argue that although such transformations are possible, God institutes a habitual course of nature: “The idea is that although God is free to bring about whatever he desires in any order at all, the actual sequence of events that he creates in the world is regular” (Ibid.). As such, we can rely on our normal inferences about how events unfold in the world.

e. Averroes’ Response to the Charge of Unbelief

Averroes (Ibn Rushd) provide a systematic response to the Incoherence of the Philosophers in his Incoherence of the Incoherence. It is beyond the scope of this article to discuss Averroes’ specific responses to al-Ghazālī’s criticisms. But in his Decisive Treatise Averroes provides a philosophical and legal defense of the compatibility of philosophy with Islam, and al-Farabi and Avicenna as Islamic philosophers, that is worth briefly delving into.

According to Averroes, philosophy is obligatory according to scripture and law, because there are a variety of verses that call for a rational reflection on the nature of the world, which amounts to philosophical activity. Furthermore, Averroes claims that studying ancient philosophers is obligatory for the qualified Muslim—the one with intellect and moral virtue—because it is necessary to see what philosophical progress has already been made, in order to make further philosophical developments.

However, there seems to be a conflict between philosophical truth and religious truth when one looks at scripture. According to Averroes, however, there are no distinct standards of truth, for truth cannot contradict truth. When it comes to interpreting scripture from a philosophical perspective, then, one must engage in appropriate forms of allegorical interpretation in order for scripture to conform with demonstrated truths. An allegorical interpretation must be offered for metaphysical claims in scripture whose literal meaning does not conform to a demonstrated metaphysical truth. For example, a verse of scripture that implies that God has hands is problematic because God is not corporeal. However, the reference to God’s hands can be allegorically interpreted as an indication of God’s power. Engaging in allegorical interpretation, however, is only appropriate for philosophers who are capable of logical demonstrations, it is not suitable for the masses or even the theologians.

The philosophers who do engage in allegorical interpretation, have some leeway with respect to making errors because there isn’t consensus amongst scholars about metaphysical issues in the Qur’an in particular. Indeed, it seems that there can’t be a consensus—or at least it is difficult to establish consensus—because scholars hold on to the principle that interpretations of esoteric and theoretical matters should not be divulged to others. A philosopher, then, can assent to (what may turn out to be) false allegorical interpretation, and still be a Muslim. Applying this view of unbelief to al-Farabi and Avicenna, Averroes argues that al-Ghazālī’s condemnation of al-Farabi and Avicenna can only be tentative because there is no consensus amongst the scholars about theoretical matters about the eternity of the world, God’s knowledge, and bodily resurrection.

5. Revival of the Religious Sciences

The Revival of the Religious Sciences constitutes al-Ghazālī’s magnum opus. The primary purpose of the Revival of the Religious Sciences is ethical and spiritual in nature, as al-Ghazālī aims to instruct the reader in both theory and practice that will lead to spiritual enlightenment and an experiential knowledge of God. This section will briefly consider al-Ghazālī’s views on the heart, intellect, Sufism, and theodicy that arise across the Revival of the Religious Sciences.

a. The Heart

The non-physical heart, according to al-Ghazālī, it is a “subtle tenuous substance of an ethereal spiritual sort, which is connected with the physical heart” (Marvels of the Heart: 6). The heart in this sense constitutes “the real essence of man” (Ibid.). Furthermore, it is through the perception of the heart that human beings can understand reality, by reflecting reality in the mirror of the heart:

In its relationship to the real nature of intelligibles, it is like a mirror in its relationship to the forms of changing appearances. For even as that which changes has a form, and the image of that form is reflected in the mirror and represented therein, so also every intelligible has its specific nature, and this specific nature has a form that is reflected and made manifest in the mirror of the heart. Even as the mirror is one thing, the forms of individuals another, and the representation of their image in the mirror another, being thus to see things in all, so here, too, there are three things: the heart, the specific natures of things, and the representation and presence of these in the heart. (Ibid. 35)

Al-Ghazālī identifies five different reasons why a heart will fail to understand reality, that is, perceive the real nature of intelligible (Ibid. 36-38). First, there may be an imperfection in the constitution of the heart’s mirror. Second, the mirror of the heart may be dull due to acts of disobedience, which preclude the “purity and cleanness of heart”. Third, the heart may not be directed to reality due to the person being excessively preoccupied with his appetites and worldly pursuits (such as wealth and livelihood). Fourth, there is a veil that can block even the obedient who has conquered his appetites and devoted himself to understanding reality. This veil constitutes theological and legal beliefs that one has accepted blindly from their youth. These beliefs can “harden the soul,” constituting a veil between the person and their perception of reality. Fifth, in order to obtain knowledge of the unknown, a person must be able to place his prior knowledge in a “process of deduction” to find the “direction of the thing sought”:

For the things that are not instinctive, which one desires to know, cannot be caught save in the net of acquired knowledge; indeed, no items of knowledge is acquired except from two preceding items of knowledge that are related and combined in a special way, and from their combination a third item of knowledge is gained. (Ibid. 38)

In other words, logic and knowledge of syllogisms in particular are necessary to comprehend the true nature of the intelligible.

The primary upshot is that in order for a person to understand reality they must, broadly construed, be in a state of obedience and their heart must be purified. According to al-Ghazālī, “the purpose of improvement is to achieve the illumination of faith in it; I mean the shining of the light of knowledge [of God]” (Ibid. 41). The illumination of faith comes in three degrees, according to al-Ghazālī: faith based on blind imitation (what the masses possess), faith-based on partial logical reasoning (what the theologians possess), and faith based on the light of certainty (what the Sufis possess).

To illustrate the difference between these degrees of faith, al-Ghazālī offers the following example. Suppose that Zayd is in a house. One way of arriving at the belief that Zayd is in the house is to be told that he is in the house by someone trustworthy and truthful. This is blind imitation and the lowest level of faith. The second way of arriving at the belief that Zayd is in the house is by hearing the voice of Zayd from inside the house. This is a stronger form of faith, as it is based on a type of experience of Zayd, and not mere hearsay. But this type of belief requires logical reasoning, as there is an inference made from hearing Zayd’s voice to the conclusion that he is in the house. The third way of arriving at the belief that Zayd is in the house is to go inside the house and see Zayd within it. This is experiential knowledge that possesses the light of certainty. This is the level of belief and faith that should be the goal of the believer (see section c. on Sufism and Ethics, below).

b. The Intellect

According to al-Ghazālī, the seat of knowledge is the spiritual heart. The intellect is a faculty of the heart, which he defines as “an expression for the heart in which there exists the image of the specific nature of things.” (Marvels of the Heart: 35). In the Book of Knowledge, al-Ghazālī distinguishes four different senses of the intellect and divides it into various categories of knowledge. Before explaining these different senses, however, it will be useful to discuss al-Ghazālī’s views on the original condition (fiṭra) of the human being.

In the Deliverance from Error, al-Ghazālī writes that:

Man’s essence, in his original condition, is created in blank simplicity without any information about the “worlds” of God Most High…. Man get his information about the “worlds” by means of perception. Each one of his kind of perception is created in order that man may get to know thereby a “world” of the existents—and by “worlds” we mean the categories of existing things. (Deliverance: 83)

Here, al-Ghazālī seems to espouse the Lockean tabula rasa claim, namely, that the mind is initially devoid of any information, and that all information is ultimately acquired through perception. On this view, then, the intellect would acquire its information through empirical means, that is, through perception. This would make al-Ghazālī close to Avicenna on this matter; although there is some scholarly debate as to whether primary truths or axiomatic knowledge is acquired via perception. Nonetheless, according to Alexander Treiger (2012), al-Ghazālī’s four-part division of the intellect is partly indebted to Avicenna’s conception of the intellect. The first three stages of intellect in particular correspond to Avicenna’s conceptions of the material intellect, the intellect in habitu, and the actual intellect. For Avicenna, the material intellect is devoid of content, consisting in only a disposition to acquire information; the intellect in habitu is the stage of intellection where primary truths are abstracted from sensory experience; and the actual intellect is the stage of intellection where the intellect has access to and understanding of the intelligible.

According to al-Ghazālī, the order of perceptual capacities created in man is touch, sight, hearing, taste, discernment (around the age of seven), and then the intellect which perceives things “not found in the previous stages” (Ibid. 83) On the first meaning of the intellect, the intellect “is the attribute that differentiates human beings from all other animals and affords them the ability to apprehend the speculative sciences and to organize the subtle rational disciplines” (Book of Knowledge: 253). In other words, the intellect is a distinctive quality of human beings to understand theoretical matters, which is not shared by other animals.

On the second meaning of the intellect, the intellect “is the science that comes or types of knowledge that come into being in the disposition of the child” (Ibid. 255). More specifically, these types of knowledge concern possibility, necessity, and impossibility, such as the knowledge that “two is more than one, and that one person cannot be in two places at the same time.” According to al-Ghazālī, this type of axiomatic knowledge does not come about through blind imitation or instruction but is an endowment to the soul. This is different from acquired knowledge, which is acquired through learning and deduction (Marvels of the Heart: 45). Furthermore, axiomatic knowledge enters the disposition of the child after sensory perception has been created in the child.

On the third meaning of the intellect, the intellect “is the sciences derived through the observation of events and circumstances as they arise” (Ibid.). In other words, the intellect at this stage allows for the rational processing of empirical events. On the fourth meaning of the intellect, the intellect is “the capacity to discern the consequences of one’s actions” (Ibid.). More specifically, it includes the capacity to overcome one’s own desires that motivate one towards immediate pleasures. This sense of intellect is also what distinguishes human beings from animals. This fourth sense of the intellect is “the final fruit and its ultimate goal” (Book of Knowledge: 256). (For alternative conceptions of the intellect in al-Ghazālī’s work see Treiger 2012)

c. Sufism and Ethics

According to al-Ghazālī, a central goal of Sufism is not a discursive understanding of God, but an experiential one. The concept al-Ghazālī employs for experiencing the divine is dhawq or fruition experience:

It became clear to me that their [the Sufis] most distinctive characteristic is something that can be attained, not by study, but rather by fruitful experience and the state of ecstasy and “the exchange of qualities.” How great a difference there is between your knowing the definitions and causes and conditions of health and satiety and your being healthy and sated! And how great a difference there is between your knowing the definition of drunkenness…and your actually being drunk! (Deliverance: 78)

Dhawq is a type of knowledge-by-acquaintance, an unmediated experience of the divine (gnosis), as opposed to propositional knowledge of God that would depend on prior beliefs and inferences. Al-Ghazālī claims that this is the highest type of knowledge one can attain, superior even to proofs of God and faith. Ultimately, to verify the Sufi claim that an experiential knowledge of God is possible, one must embark on the Sufi path.

Broadly construed, the means to attaining dhawq is through purifying the heart, that is, ridding it of spiritual diseases and replacing it with virtues. As we have seen, for al-Ghazālī, the spiritual heart is the seat of perception, intelligence, and knowledge, and the primary function of “the heart being the acquisition of wisdom and gnosis, which is the specific property of the human soul which distinguishes man from animals” (Discipling the Soul: 46-47). However, the heart has to be in the right condition to acquire knowledge generally. It must be in a purified-disciplined state to acquire the experiential knowledge of God. To do so, the believer must engage in a variety of spiritual practices.

In Marvels of the Heart, al-Ghazālī explains, in general, the method of the Sufis for purifying the heart. First, the believer must cut off ties with the present world by “taking away concern for family, possessions, children, homeland, knowledge, rule, and rank” (Marvels of the Heart: 54). Then, he must withdraw into a private place of seclusion in order to fulfill the obligatory and supererogatory religious duties: “He must sit with an empty heart” and “strive [such] that nothing save God, the Exalted, shall come into his mind” (Ibid.) Next, in his seclusion, he must repeatedly recite the name of God (Allah) with his heart fixed on God, until “the form and letters of the expression and the very appearance of the word is effaced from the heart and there remains present in it nought save the ideal meaning” (Marvels of the Heart: 54-55). Engaging in these practices seems to be a necessary, but not sufficient condition for an unveiling of the divine realities. According to al-Ghazālī, it is ultimately up to God’s mercy to grant the believer gnosis if, again, he has purified his heart: “By what he has done thus far he has exposed himself to the breezes of God’s mercy, and it only remains for him to wait for such mercy” (Marvels of the Heart: 55).

In Discipling the Soul, al-Ghazālī lays out an ethical program for cultivating good character that is necessary for acquiring gnosis. Here, we interestingly see the influences of Ancient Greek virtue ethics on al-Ghazālī’s ethical thought. According to al-Ghazālī, a character trait “is a firmly established condition of the soul, from which actions proceed easily without any need for thinking or forethought” (Disciplining the Soul: 17). Good character traits lead to beautiful acts, whereas bad character traits lead to ugly acts. Character, however, is not the same as action, rather it is a “term for the condition and inner aspect of the soul.” (Ibid. 18).

According to al-Ghazālī, the fundamental character traits are wisdom, courage, temperance, and justice, from which a variety of other character traits derive (Ibid. 18-19). According to al-Ghazālī, wisdom is the condition of the soul that allows it to distinguish truth from falsity in all acts of volition. Justice is the condition of the soul that controls desire through wisdom. Courage is when the intellect exerts control over anger or the irascible faculty. Temperance is the control of the appetitive faculty through the intellect and religious law. The purpose of cultivating this character is ultimately to cut off the love of the world way to make space for the love of God in the heart (Ibid. 33).

The key to curing the diseases of the heart, according to al-Ghazālī, ultimately comes down to renouncing one’s desires. Al-Ghazālī writes that the essence of self-discipline consists in the soul “not taking pleasure in anything which will not be present in the grave” (Ibid. 60). The believer should restrict the fulfillment of their desires to the absolute necessities of life (for example, food, marriage, and clothing), and occupy their time in devotion to God. The believer who is solely occupied with the remembrance of God in this way is one of the “Truthful Saints” (Ibid.)

d. Theodicy: The Best of All Possible Worlds

In Faith in Divine Unity and Trust in Divine Providence, al-Ghazālī makes a remarkable claim, (anticipating Leibniz’s optimism) about the omnipotence and benevolence of God, namely, that God created the best of all possible worlds: “Nor is anything more fitting, more perfect, and more attractive within the realm of possibility” (Faith in Divine Unity: 45-6) (Similarly, in Principles of the Creed, al-Ghazālī writes that everything “proceeds forth from His justice in the best, most perfect, most complete, and most equitable way” [Principles of the Creed: 14]). This constitutes a theodicy for the existence of evil in the actual world. Here is the immediate context for this claim:

For everything which God Most High distributes among His servants: care and an appointed time, happiness and sadness, weakness and power, faith and unbelief, obedience and apostasy—all of it is unqualifiedly just with no injustice in it, true with no wrong infecting it. Indeed, all this happens according to a necessary and true order, according to what is appropriate as it is appropriate and in the measure that is proper to it; nor is anything more fitting, more perfect, and more attractive within the realm of possibility. For if something were to exist and remind one of the sheer omnipotence [of God] and not of the good things accomplished by His action, that would utterly contradict [God’s] generosity, and be an in justice contrary to the Just One. And if God were not omnipotent, He would be impotent, thereby contradicting the nature of divinity. (Faith in Divine Unity: 45-6)

According to al-Ghazālī, the world and existence more generally reflect God’s complete benevolence and justice. God’s maximal power that is manifested in the creation of the existing world is balanced by his maximal benevolence. As Ormsby puts it in his seminal study of this text, al-Ghazālī’s arguments for having trust in God in part depends on divine providence and the actual world being the best of all possible worlds:

The aspirant to trust in God must therefore learn to see the world as it really is—not as the product of blind chance or of any series of causes and effects, nor as the arena of his own endeavors, but as the direct expression of the divine will and wisdom, down to the least particular. Trust in God presupposes the recognition of the perfect Rightness of the actual. (1984: 43)

Al-Ghazālī, however, received much criticism for his best-of-all-possible world thesis by later theologians. Broadly construed, three primary and interrelated criticisms were raised (Ormsby 1984; cf. Ogden 2016). The first criticism is that, in terms of possibility, the actual world is not the best of all possible worlds as it certainly could be improved upon in terms of reducing suffering and increasing goodness. The second criticism is that al-Ghazālī was following the views of the philosophers in thinking that the world is created by a natural necessity, in that God’s creation necessarily emanates from his essence and relatedly, that since God is perfect, the creation that follows from his essence is necessarily perfect as well. This conflicts with the view that God has freedom and decrees what he wills. The third criticism is that al-Ghazālī’s best of all possible worlds thesis is dangerously close to a Mu’tazilite doctrine according to which God is obligated to do the best for creation. This conflicts with Ash’arite doctrine according to which God is not obligated to create at all, because he is omnipotent and no constraints can be placed on Him.

6. Islamic Philosophy after Al-Ghazālī

Al-Ghazālī, with his writing of the Incoherence of the Philosophers and his condemnation of al-Farabi and Avicenna, is often charged with causing a decline of philosophy and science in the Islamic world. After al-Ghazālī, the thought goes, Islamic intellectuals abandoned philosophical and scientific inquiry in favor of mysticism, theology, and the traditional Islamic sciences. As Steven Weinberg writes:

Alas, Islam turned against science in the twelfth century. The most influential figure was the philosopher Abu Hamid al-Ghazālī, who argued in The Incoherence of the Philosophers against the very idea of laws of nature…after al-Ghazālī, there was no more science worth mentioning in Islamic countries. (2007)

In Montgomery Watt’s view, such a charge against al-Ghazālī is unjustified because Islamic philosophy was arguably already on the decline after the death of Avicenna:

It is tempting to conclude that his attack on the philosophers had been so devastating that philosophy was killed off; but such a conclusion is not justified. It is true that there were not outstanding philosophers in the east after 1100 who stood within the ‘pure’ Aristotelian and Neoplatonic tradition; but it is also true that the last great philosopher there, Avicenna, had died in 1037; twenty years before al-Ghazālī was born; and so the decline of philosophy may have begun long before the Tahāfut [Incoherence of the Philosophers] appeared. (1962: 91)

According to other scholars, however, it is simply false that there was a decline in philosophy after the appearance of the Incoherence of the Philosophers. While the Incoherence of the Philosophers may have convinced certain orthodox thinkers to steer clear of philosophy and even encouraged some persecution, the Islamic philosophical tradition lived on. As Frank Griffel argues: “If al-Ghazālī tried to establish thought-police in Islam, he remained unsuccessful. There was simply no Inquisition in Islam” (2007: 158). In addition to Averroes, who wrote the Incoherence of the Incoherence, there is a rich tradition of post-classical Islamic philosophy full of a variety of Islamic philosophers that have been neglected in the story of Islamic philosophy (for example, Suhrawardī and the illuminations school of thought). As such, while al-Ghazālī’s Incoherence of the Philosophers was influential, it arguably did not put an end to philosophy in the Islamic world.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Al-Ghazālī. 1980. Deliverance from Error. Translated by R.J. McCarthy. Louisville: Fons Vitae.
Al-Ghazālī. 1998. The Niche of Lights: A Parallel English-Arabic Text. Edited and Translated by D. Buchman. Provo: Brigham Young University Press.
Al-Ghazālī. 2000. The Incoherence of the Philosophers: A Parallel English-Arabic Text. Edited and Translated. By M.E. Marmura, 2nd ed. Provo: Brigham Young University Press.
Al-Ghazālī. 2001. Kitāb al-Tawḥid wa’l-Tawakkul (Faith in Divine Unity and Trust in Divine Providence) [Book XXXV]. Translated by D.B. Burrell. Louisville: Fons Vitae.
Al-Ghazālī. 2002. On the Boundaries of Theological Tolerance in Islam: Abu Hamid al-Ghazālī’s Faysal al-Tafriqa. Trans. by S.A. Jackson. Karachi: Oxford University Press.
Al-Ghazālī. 2010. Kitāb sharḥ ‘ajā’ib al-qalb (The Marvels of the Heart) [Book XXI]. Translated by W.J. Skellie. Louisville: Fons Vitae.
Al-Ghazālī. 2013. Al-Ghazali’s Moderation in Belief. Translated by A.M. Yaqub. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Al-Ghazālī. 2015. Kitāb al-‘ilm (The Book of Knowledge) [Book I]. Translated by K. Honerkamp. Louisville: Fons Vitae.
Al-Ghazālī. 2016. Kitāb qawā‘id al-‘aqā’id (The Principles of the Creed) [Book II]. Translated by K. Williams. Louisville: Fons Vitae.
Al-Ghazālī. 2016. On Disciplining the Soul and On Breaking the Two Desires: Books XXII and XXIII of the Revival of the Religious Sciences. Translated By T.J. Winter. Cambridge: The Islamic Texts Society.
Averroes. 1954. Averroes’ Tahafut Al-Tahafut (The Incoherence of the Incoherence). Translated by S. van den Bergh, 2 vols., London: Luzac.
Averroes. 2001. The Book of the Decisive Treatise Determining the Connection Between Law and Wisdom. Edited and Translated by C. Butterworth. Provo: Brigham Young University Press.
Avicenna. 2005. The Metaphysics of The Healing: A Parallel English-Arabic Text. Edited and Translated by M.E. Marmura. Provo: Brigham Young University Press.

b. Secondary Sources

Abrahamov, Binyamin. 1988. “Al-Ghazālī’s Theory of Causality.” Studia Islamica 67: 75-98.
Abrahamov, Binyamin. 1993. “Al-Ghazālī’s Supreme Way to Know God.” Studia Islamica 77: 141-168.
Ai-Allaf, Mashhad. 2006. “Al-Ghazālī on Logical Necessity, Causality, and Miracles.” Journal of Islamic Philosophy 2 (1): 37-52.
Albertini, Tamara. 2005. “Crisis and Certainty of Knowledge in Al-Ghazālī and Descartes.” Philosophy East and West 55: 1-14.
Azadpur, Mohammad. 2003. “Unveiling the Hidden: On the Meditations of Descartes & al-Ghazālī.” In The Passions of the Soul: A Dialogue Between Phenomenology and Islamic Philosophy, edited by Anna-Teresa Tymieniecka, 219-240. Kluwer.
Belo, C. 2006. “Averroes on God’s Knowledge of Particulars.” Journal of Islamic Studies 17 (2): 177-199.
Burrell, David B. 1987. “The Unknowability of God in Al-Ghazali.” Religious Studies 23 (2): 171-182.
Campanini, Massimo. 2018. Al-Ghazali and the Divine. New York: Routledge.
Dutton, Blake. 2001. “Al-Ghazālī on Possibility and the Critique of Causality.” Medieval Philosophy and Theology 10 (1): 23-46.
Ferhat, Loumia. 2020. “Al-Ghazālī’s Heart as a Medium of Light: Illumination and the Soteriological Process.” Journal of Islamic Ethics 4 (1-2): 201-222.
Goodman, Lenn Evan. 1978. “Did Al-Ghazālī Deny Causality?” Studia Islamica 47: 83-120.
Götz, Ignacio. 2003. “The Quest for Certainty: Al-Ghazālī and Descartes.” Journal of Philosophical Research 28: 1–22.
Griffel, Frank. 2001. “Toleration and Exclusion: Al-Shāfiʾī and al-Ghazālī on the Treatment of Apostates.” Bulletin of the School of Oriental and African Studies, University of London 64 (3): 339-354.
Griffel, Frank. 2005. “Taqlîd of the Philosophers. Al-Ghazâlî’s Initial Accusation in the Tahâfut.” In Ideas, Images, and Methods of Portrayal. Insights into Arabic Literature and Islam, edited by S. Günther, 253-273. Leiden: Brill.
Griffel, Frank. 2009. al-Ghazālī’s Philosophical Theology. New York: Oxford University Press.
Griffel, Frank. 2011. “The Western Reception of al-Ghazālī’s Cosmology from the Middle Ages to the 21st Century.” Dîvân: Disiplinlerarası Çalışmalar Dergisi/Dîvân: Journal of Interdisciplinary Studies 16: 33-62.
Griffel, Frank. 2012. “Al-Ghazālī’s Use of “Original Human Disposition” (Fiṭra) and Its Background in the Teachings of Al-Fārābī and Avicenna.” The Muslim World 102 (1): 1-32.
Griffel, Frank. 2021. The Formation of Post-Classical Philosophy in Islam. New York: Oxford University Press.
Hadisi, Reza. 2022. “Ghazālī’s Transformative Answer to Scepticism.” Theoria 88 (1): 109-142.
Hasan, Ali. 2013. “Al-Ghazali and Ibn Rushd (Averroes) on Creation and the Divine Attributes,” In Models of God and Alternative Ultimate Realities, edited by Jeanine Diller & Asa Kasher, 141-156. The Netherlands: Springer.
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Author Information

Saja Paravizian
Email: sparavizian@outlook.com
University of Illinois, Chicago
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy