Epistemic Injustice

The term “epistemic injustice” refers to the existence of a distinctive type of injustice in which a wrong is done to someone specifically in their capacity as a knower. Philosophers working at the intersection of epistemology and ethics under the general umbrella of virtue ethics have recognized that individuals are not given adequate credit for their claims, which results in a credibility deficit that harms them in their capacity as rational agents and as knowers. The first explicit and groundbreaking account of epistemic injustice was given by Fricker in 2007. This article begins by providing a schematic overview of her influential account. It then examines in more detail the two main forms of epistemic injustice and her suggestions for overcoming them. It concludes with a brief survey of subsequent work that critically extends her initial account. An attractive feature of work on epistemic injustice concerns its attention to the central connections between moral value, knowledge, and power, especially as these intersect within the complex practices of everyday human lives. The harms of being denied credibility based on gender, political identity, or socioeconomic class, all highlight forms of epistemic injustice that matter to us and need to be overcome. As a contribution to social philosophy, this article highlights how these harms of epistemic injustice rest on flawed epistemic practices from the standpoint of human agents situated in complex social situations.

Epistemic Injustice: A Brief Overview
Testimonial Injustice and Social Power
Stereotypes, Prejudice and Testimonial Injustice
The Wrong of Testimonial Injustice
The Virtue of Testimonial Justice
Hermeneutical Injustice
The Wrong of Interpretive Injustice and the Virtue of Hermeneutical Justice
Extensions and Challenges
References and Further Reading

1. Epistemic Injustice: A Brief Overview

The introduction of this article is designed to highlight the existence of a distinctive type of injustice where a wrong is done to someone specifically in their capacity as a knower (Fricker 2007, 1). In Fricker’s canonical account, epistemic injustice is presented as occurring in two basic forms: testimonial injustice and hermeneutical injustice. The first occurs when prejudice or bias causes a hearer to give a deflated level of credibility to what someone says, while the second happens at an earlier stage, when a gap in our collective interpretive resources unfairly disadvantages someone in terms of understanding their own specific social experiences. These two injustices highlight ethical features of our everyday practices of knowing, where these emerge due to the use of social power within our epistemic relationships and interactions.

In order to properly locate these forms of injustice a fuller account of social power is needed, which Fricker understands as a socially situated capacity to control other’s actions. Of special interest is the specific type of social power called ‘identity power’ that is dependent on a shared understanding of social identities during the use of social power. Inequalities in social power help to create testimonial injustices, where prejudice causes the hearer to give less credibility to a speaker than is deserved. The key type of prejudice in such cases is identity prejudice, where the injustice suffered by a speaker is due to an identity prejudice held by the hearer, and it is this bias that results in a credibility deficit. The central case of testimonial injustice then turns on this identity-prejudicial credibility deficit (2007, 28). The identity prejudice that leads to testimonial injustice is enabled through the use of the social power described as identity power.

Identity prejudice influences a hearer’s judgments about speaker credibility by way of ‘social imagination’ where this involves prejudicial stereotypes as distorted images of social types (e.g. immigrants are lazy). Fricker views credibility judgements as a type of perception, so the negative impact of prejudice and stereotypes is measured in terms of the way these serve to distort our perceptions of someone’s credibility.

The nature of the ethical wrong done to the speaker in cases of testimonial injustice is that they are harmed in their capacity as a knower, as a giver of knowledge or informant. This capacity is further recognized as essential to human value and experience. As a result, this primary ethical harm is an intrinsic injustice, as it is tied to the value of one’s own personal identity as a knower. As we will see, experiencing this harm can result in serious negative consequences for one’s self-development.

Identity prejudice and its consequent epistemic harms are at the root of a further type of epistemic injustice known as hermeneutical injustice or interpretive injustice (these terms will be used interchangeably). This injustice is the result of having some important part of one’s social experience discounted because of a gap in society’s collective interpretive resources. Without the concepts necessary to make sense of this experience the individual suffers epistemic harm. By contrast to the case of testimonial injustice, the prejudice that disables individuals from sharing their experiences is structural, as it indicates a lacuna in the social environment within which we make sense of human experience. This gap in interpretive resources leads to stereotypical identity evaluations that can be prejudicial precisely because they fail to engage with the experiences of the individual. Consider the case of post-partum depression prior to its recognition as a serious medical condition. Women suffering from this depression would be met with suspicion by husbands, doctors and friends concerning the condition. Their experiences are not taken seriously as they would simply be viewed within the existing conceptual repertoire available, precisely because the social interpretive resources available cannot make sense of this experience as a genuine medical condition suffered by women. The lack of credibility given these women is the result of a prejudice that is built into the very social conditions of interpretation, which prove insufficient to make sense of their individual experience.

In both the cases of testimonial and interpretive injustice, identity prejudice then serves as the main cause of injustice. The exploration below of these types of injustice in more detail shows the virtue of epistemic justice offered as a local, transactional remedy for minimizing such forms of prejudice.

2. Testimonial Injustice and Social Power

We have been introduced to the idea that social power as a socially situated capacity to control other’s actions further results in the use of identity power as contributing to the central case of testimonial injustice involving identity prejudice. In this section we explore this use of social power and its connection to testimonial justice in greater detail.

We first begin with one of Fricker’s central illustrations. Consider the following example from the screenplay The Talented Mr. Ripley, when Herbert Greenleaf attempts to further understand what might have led to the disappearance of his son Dickie. Greenleaf silences his son’s fiancée Marge Sherwood, dismissing her suspicion concerning the circumstances of Dickie’s disappearance, and the further suggestion that Mr. Ripley may be somehow behind it (Fricker 2007, 9). Marge’s suspicion is based on the surprising fact that Ripley has Dickie’s rings, which Dickie told Marge he would never remove. Greenleaf interprets Marge’s suspicion as a case of ‘female intuition’, which is emotional and not based on facts. Here Greenleaf’s male identity enables him to silence and control Marge, resulting in a clear use of social power as identity power. This results in his use of a gender identity prejudice against her ability to offer credible testimony in this emotionally charged situation.

The type of social power briefly illustrated here, is defined as the “capacity we have as social agents to influence how things go in the social world” (2007, 9). To claim that power is a capacity is to affirm its existence even when not in active use. It then has both an active and passive dimension, where its passive force can diminish when not actively used. For example, the periodic giving of parking tickets by the traffic warden is an active use of power that remains in effect passively when tickets are not given. A further contrast can be drawn in terms of agential and structural power. The first requires the exercise of passive or active power on the part of an agent, where the second requires no such agent, but is spread out across the social system or part of the system in question. An example of such structural power would be some minority social group that tends not to vote. The fact that this group fails to vote is attributed to the structural power that operates on them in such a way that they do not exercise their voting rights.

However, the first type of agential power still depends on social structure, since its effective exercise depends on practical coordination with other social agents. When university professors assign grades, this capacity is dependent on a whole host of administrators to be effective. The key point here is that all relations of power, whether agential or structural, depend on the specific social alignments of people. In addition, there is more to be said of social power beyond this basic idea of sociability, since Fricker rejects the classic definition of power given by Lukes involving the disruption of someone’s interests (1974). In Fricker’s view, this perspective is far too narrow, since the use of power is not always against other’s interests. For example, students accept the professor’s power to assign grades. The key feature of this use of social power is then to “effect social control” (Fricker 2007, 13).

This view can be seen in both types of power we have considered. In agential power, someone controls the actions of another person or group. With the case of structural power there is no agent, but the actions of the group are still subject to control by means of the social structure in which they find themselves. Such structural uses of power work to create social order. With the example of nonvoting groups, we see that a complex network of institutions, laws and their implementation can result in some groups engaging in forms of nonaction that undermine their basic rights. We are thus led to the following working definition of social power: “a practically socially situated capacity to control others’ actions, where this capacity may be exercised (actively or passively) by particular social agents, or alternatively, it may operate purely structurally” (Fricker 2007, 13). This definition is neutral with regard to the possible uses of power, yet still captures what we might see as its core, critical function against attributions of power and social control. Whenever we recognize power being used, we should ask who is using this power, for what reasons, and who exactly are they controlling or attempting to control.

We now need to consider the more specific type of social power that Fricker calls ‘identity power’ (2007, 14-17). Here we have a case of social power that is dependent on a shared view of social identity. Such identity power can also be both passive and active, as illustrated in terms of gender with the example of The Talented Mr. Ripley and Herbert Greenleaf’s treatment of his son’s fiancée Marge. Greenleaf’s use of identity power is active, since he uses it to silence her. But it might also be exercised passively, since she could be silenced without him doing anything at all. It is important to note that the participants in a social interaction need not accept the social stereotypes that promote the use of identity power in that situation for the operation of social power to work. Identity power works at the level of “collective social imagination” (2007, 15). It is able to control actions whether we accept it or believe it. Identity power can further operate with other forms of social power, such as material forms of social power. For examples, see (Fricker 2007, 15-6). There can also be structural operations of identity power. This can once again be seen in the case of the non-voting group. The members of this group have adopted a social identity that includes the view that its members tend not to vote. This then further supports their resulting decision not to vote.

The key issue with regards to identity power is the way it forms an important part of the mechanism of testimonial exchange. This is because we frequently appeal to the use of social stereotypes in order to make credibility judgements concerning what others say. This use of stereotypes may be acceptable or not depending on the actual stereotype used. If a stereotype promotes a bias, or prejudice that works against the speaker, it can result in a loss of knowledge, since a low biased judgment of the speaker’s credibility results in failure to learn what the speaker may know. This further results in an ethical problem since the speaker is harmed by our wrongly undermining their capacity as a knower.

The core case of this epistemic injustice is found with Fricker’s emphasis on ‘testimonial Injustice’. Generally, there are two kinds of prejudice used in testimony: ones that lead to credibility excess and those that lead to credibility deficit. In any face-to-face discussion we need to make an attribution of credibility. Error is no doubt part of that process, but generally assignments of excess credibility are advantageous, while those involving a credibility deficit are disadvantageous. Fricker argues that the central cases of testimonial injustice involve credibility deficit, precisely because it is here that one is most clearly wronged in their capacity as a knower. Below, we will see that Fricker has been effectively criticized on this point. Given the fallible nature of human judgment, assigning an unfair level of credibility to someone can often occur. However, in cases where no prejudice is involved no ethical or epistemic harm has been done (2007, 21-22). The source of testimonial injustice is found in the prejudice or bias that results in an unfair and harmful lowering of a speaker’s credibility. Fricker concludes that the central cases of testimonial injustice involve identity-prejudicial credibility deficit (2007, 28).

In sum, social power in the form of identity power plays a fundamental role in undermining the credibility of speakers. It enables negative prejudice to influence our judgements of others’ testimony leading to epistemic injustice.

3. Stereotypes, Prejudice and Testimonial Injustice

We saw that the central cases of testimonial injustice turn on the way identity power is used to prejudice the judgement of someone’s credibility as an informant. Such uses of identity power further depend on the ease with which we communicate. In this section, we consider how communication enables prejudicial negative judgments through our use of stereotypes.

In order to effectively engage in communication, we must swiftly assess the credibility of what is said. This is accomplished through the use of stereotypes concerning the speakers we confront. This helps facilitate the ease with which we are able communicate with others. However, while the use of stereotypes is indispensable, it can be prejudicial thereby corrupting these judgements of speaker credibility. Fricker provides an in-depth examination of how prejudicial stereotypes negatively influence our credibility judgments.

Stereotypes are defined as “widely held associations between a given social group and one or more attributes” (2007, 30). This definition is broad in the following three central ways:

It is neutral with respect to the reliability of the generalization made using a stereotype.
It highlights other types of cognitive commitments. Stereotypes need not be held as beliefs but can include feelings that are less transparent than beliefs.
It is open to stereotypes being positive or negative (2007, 30).

The value of stereotype use can be seen by looking briefly at the nature of testimonial exchange. In such situations we are faced with the following sort of question: How do I immediately determine how likely what is said is true? Here, one makes a credibility judgment about epistemic trustworthiness, where this includes both the competency and sincerity of those of a specific social type. It is then, as Fricker further argues, both inevitable and desirable that hearers use generalizations based on reliable stereotypes. Familiar examples would include social stereotypes about the local family doctor, or neighborhood shop keeper. Everyday dialogue requires the kind of social categorization in the form of stereotypes that makes possible discussion and communication.

What then may happen within testimonial contexts is an identity prejudice that influences the use of stereotypes. This point can be further explored through the use of an example from Arpaly, the case of Solomon, as it highlights the difference between a non-culpable epistemic error and negative prejudicial judgments (Arpaly 2003, 103; 2007, 33-34). Stated briefly, Solomon, a boy growing up in a small rural community, is raised to believe that women are not inclined to abstract thinking and therefore are not as good abstract thinkers as men. In his local environment, he faces no counter evidence to this view, and so he is not proceeding irrationally. But once he enters university and now studies beside very capable female students, to continue to hold his previous belief would be irrational and the result of prejudice. Fricker concludes from this case that not all prejudice involves ethical mistakes or flaws (2007, 34). However, once Solomon arrives at university, this changes. Here, the prejudice in question becomes a negative identity prejudice, the central case of testimonial injustice, where it gives rise to a firmly held belief that is accompanied by morally suspect feelings about a group of individuals. A negative identity prejudicial stereotype that is at work in such cases of systematic testimonial injustice is then defined as “A widely held disparaging association between a social group and one or more attributes, where this association embodies a generalization that displays some (typically, epistemically culpable) resistance to counter-evidence owing to an ethically bad affective investment” (2007, 35). Here the stereotypical association is maintained in the face of contrary evidence due to morally suspect feelings one may have about a group. Not revising one’s belief in such circumstances reveals an epistemic failing that yields an epistemic injustice.

We can apply this clarified understanding of stereotypical associations and their role in identity prejudice to the case of our everyday talk with others. In such discussions, speakers and hearers perceive others as trustworthy, in being both sincere and competent concerning what is said. One may perceive someone’s testimony in terms of background assumptions about how likely this person (as a member of a social type) is to be trustworthy. In the process, reliable stereotypes are used, or, at least, they are taken to be reliable (2007, 36). However, in the case of negative identity prejudicial stereotypes, the prejudicial bias distorts this credibility judgement, resulting in its negative influence on the speaker’s perception of the speaker.

In the cases discussed so far, the prejudice in question is based on beliefs, but stereotypical associations may be based in other non-doxastic (not based on beliefs) influences on our perception of others. There is even the possibility that testimonial injustice may occur through such associations when our beliefs are inconsistent with it. Prejudicial stereotypes can then influence our credibility judgments without doxastic mediation, thereby making them very difficult to detect and correct. This non-doxastic mediation is further clarified with the work of Walter Lippmann who treats a stereotype as a social image creating an association between a social group and certain characteristics resulting in generalizations about this group (1965; Fricker 2007). Stereotypes based on this social imagery can have a deep visceral impact on judgements, influencing them without our explicit awareness. They can further influence our patterns of judgment even when the content of such imagery conflicts with our own beliefs. Fricker illustrates this conflict with the example of the feminist, who while believing in gender equality harbors seemingly negative attitudes toward female political candidates (2007, 37). In this case, her prior cognitive commitments held in imagination retain their impact concerning how she perceives the social world even after the corresponding beliefs have been explicitly rejected. As a result, they are very hard to detect and change, requiring a special kind of self-awareness or self-consciousness to see this kind of prejudice in one’s thinking and to take steps to correct it.

If images are prejudicial, they can be an ethical-epistemic liability, since they can influence our judgments without our being aware. This suggests that testimonial injustice happens often (2007, 39). We then lack a moral discourse or vocabulary necessary for the detection and criticism of these types of epistemic injustice. While the so-called social imagination leads to prejudicial images that remain difficult to detect, it also may in a more positive vein offer resources for social change. While prejudice can negatively influence perception and judgment, if the inconsistency between our imagination and belief can be brought to our attention, then our beliefs can be used to correct the prejudicial imagery. The opposite may also be possible: our prejudicial beliefs can be corrected by an unprejudiced social perception. For example, Fricker describes the case of Huckleberry Finn from Mark Twain’s The Adventures of Tom Sawyer, who believes that because Jim is a slave he has done something wrong by escaping, but still maintains an unbiased, empathic understanding of Jim as a fellow human being (2007, 40; Twain 1876). Our social imagination can then be seen as a potentially powerful force for social change. The key here is that the disagreement between social imagery and belief can serve as a crucial epistemic and ethical resource for reducing prejudice in our credibility judgements (2007, 45).

4. The Wrong of Testimonial Injustice

We have seen how prejudice can corrupt our credibility judgements leading to testimonial injustice. The next issue we must now briefly consider concerns the nature of the injustice or harm done in such cases of testimonial injustice. Initially, we can note a kind of general epistemic harm, since testimonial injustice prevents us from acquiring the possible knowledge that someone is attempting to communicate, and which we might also find helpful (2007, 43). However, even more significantly, we need to locate the precise nature of the additional ethical harm that is experienced on the part of the speaker. Here, we can follow Fricker who usefully distinguishes between primary and secondary dimensions of this harm.

The primary harm highlights how individuals are wronged in their capacity as knowers. Being treated as a purveyor of knowledge is an essential human value, so that when it is violated, one suffers an intrinsic injustice. The human capacity for the giving and sharing of knowledge and information is central to our humanity as it is crucially tied to our ability to think and reason. When this is denied us, individuals then suffer from this epistemic wrong, and further also suffer from what it means to be treated in this way. The import of this harm can be further emphasized by considering what we might call ‘epistemic trustworthiness’, which at a minimum includes both the attribution of competence and sincerity (2007, 45). In cases of testimonial injustice both of these features, when either denied singly or together, excludes one from the epistemic community. As a result, our basic capacity to reason and share knowledge is denied, which is basic to our identity as human creatures.

Secondary harms occur as further consequences of this primary harm and can be both practical and epistemic. In terms of practical consequences, we might consider one-time instances of testimonial injustice, where, for example, in a court of law, someone is found guilty rather than innocent. Additional cases might involve a case of testimonial injustice that influences someone’s working life, such that they are seen as lacking the judgment needed for a management position. Examples would include the professional disadvantages some women suffer through testimonial injustice at work. Further secondary epistemic consequences yield clear cases of epistemic harm, where there is a general loss of what might be termed one’s ‘epistemic confidence’. Here we can consider cases of persistent testimonial injustice that can lead to an overall loss of confidence in one’s general intellectual abilities, which could further hinder or limit one’s educational and intellectual development. Identity prejudice in the form of testimonial injustice can be further seen as a general attack on someone’s epistemic authority (2007, 48). It is reasonable to wonder how deep an impact such secondary effects can have in someone’s life. As has been suggested, testimonial injustice could lead to an overall loss of confidence in one’s beliefs and their justification, leading to overall lack of confidence in one’s own beliefs and possible knowledge. Of course, knowledge may also be lost as well. If this lack of confidence continues there may be a general lack of interest in inquiry or any engagement in the process of acquiring further knowledge. Perhaps less directly this loss of epistemic confidence might prevent the development of certain intellectual virtues. For example: the intellectual courage needed to examine possible views, standing firm until convinced of a mistake, or staying focused until a position is adequately defended. Such a stance requires an epistemic confidence that testimonial injustice could weaken. One’s beliefs may be given up too easily, resulting in the loss of knowledge. Furthermore, one’s intellectual character may be damaged, which plays a key role in intellectual confidence.

Consider once again Fricker’s example from The Talented Mr. Ripley, when Herbert Greenleaf unjustly silences Marge Sherwood. By using this example, we can detect the testimonial injustice he does to her, which will later help to locate the epistemic virtue he lacks and highlight the way his moral standing depends on his historical and social context. Clearly, he undermines Marge as a possessor of knowledge (2007, 87). His negative attitude towards what she says, results in his ignoring a key reason for her correct hypothesis about Ripley’s involvement with Dickie’s death. Here we have the primary harm of testimonial injustice, where he unjustly downplays Marge’s remarks. Furthermore, Marge is constructed as a hysterical individual. She becomes what she is constructed as – emotional, intuitive, and unable to see the facts for what they are. This makes it seem as if Greenleaf’s credibility judgement of her is correct (2007, 88-89). This construction of her identity is both unfair and unjust. In addition, she is in fact correct about her suspicions, and has good evidence in support of her view. Here we can note some of the epistemic consequences of the secondary harm, involving the loss of epistemic confidence that stems from one’s identity negatively shaped by an epistemic bias. Once we take all of this into account, it becomes increasingly clear that Greenleaf should give her more credibility. As we will consider further below, Greenleaf’s ability to perceive Marge as a credible witness is flawed due to the way it is in part formed through the gender prejudice of his time. We should further note this example highlights the way a hearer can clearly fail to correct the identity prejudice at work in their credibility assessments (2007, 89). Greenleaf fails to bring any critical awareness to bear on the prejudice that distorts his perception of Marge as an unreliable informant. Lastly, such reflections return us to the primary harm and its possible impact on one’s psychology. For example, Fricker describes how participation in mutually trustful dialogue is a chief part of the process for settling beliefs, and establishing one’s own identity, including social identity (2007, 53). Testimonial injustice excludes persons from the forms of trustful conversation required for the creation of these central features of personal identity. This exclusion is based on prejudice further inhibiting the development of personal identity and the formation of the self (2007, 54-55).

5. The Virtue of Testimonial Justice

We have been reviewing the serious harms that result from testimonial injustice, where the most serious involve the devaluing of someone’s capability as a sharer of knowledge. Given the severity of the harms, it is vital that we consider options for minimizing its negative influence. This issue will be explored in this section in terms of the virtue of testimonial justice. Central for this examination is Fricker’s view that a hearer’s credibility judgment be treated as a perception of the speaker as more or less trustworthy (70). A hearer’s ability to trust what is said is a capacity for a type of social perception that is informed by a background theory of the competence and motivations of social types in various social contexts (71). This further requires a well-trained ‘testimonial sensibility’, where through the right kind of epistemic socialization, a virtuous hearer gains this testimonial sensibility (72). This section provides an overview of this core idea and its importance for overcoming the negative harms seen with testimonial injustice.

Our testimonial sensibility develops through participation in and observation of practices of testimonial exchange. As a result, a body of collective and individual testimonial experiences influence the development of the testimonial sensibility required of a virtuous hearer. It is through such experiences that we learn to assume trust when it is appropriate (2007, 83). Importantly, this sensibility is not fixed or static: we can over time develop a critical attitude toward the passive inheritance that conditions our credibility judgements. This is perhaps most apparent when new experiences of testimony are in tension with past experience that has been passively shaped by our testimonial sensibility. In order to be epistemically responsible, we then need to adjust our sensibility to fit this new experience. Here we can revisit the example of the feminist who continues her dislike of female political candidates (2007, 83). Here, her sensibility needs to be critically updated in light of her feminist beliefs, with the result being a more trustworthy attitude towards the statements of females involved in politics. Through critical reflection on our perceptual habits, hearers can change their sensibility, and this can be seen as part of our maturation process in the face of new testimonial experiences. Testimonial sensibility is then viewed as a spontaneous critical sensitivity continuously adapting on the basis of new individual and collective experience.

We are then presented with a basic picture of human testimony as speakers perceiving others as more or less credible informants. Our perceptual faculty results from training that is historical, social, and individual. The existence of identity prejudice presents a danger to the ongoing development of our testimonial sensibility. With the presence of identity prejudices in our social environment, we are at risk of causing testimonial injustice, where the key case involves an identity-prejudicial credibility deficit. In order to counter this danger, we need a particular virtue, seen here as a way to prevent the harmful influence of prejudice on our credibility perceptions. Such a virtue would provide us with a kind of protection against the distorting influence of prejudice. We have already seen the kinds of epistemic harm done by Herbert Greenleaf when he unjustly silences Marge Sherwood. He undermines Marge as a possessor of knowledge, with the further consequence of weakening her confidence as an epistemic agent. Greenleaf fails to critically assess the prejudice he uses to distort his view of Marge as a reliable informant. We can now consider more precisely what sort of critical awareness was missing and the possible steps needed to prevent the harm from being done.

Our question then concerns what type of critical awareness is needed to avoid testimonial injustice (2007, 90)? The influence of a prejudicial stereotype in Greenleaf’s testimonial sensibility highlights a corrupt operation of identity power between speaker and hearer. The concept “women” yields a social stereotype that distorts the credibility judgement assigned to Marge. We earlier saw that the operation or use of identity power controls who can convey knowledge to whom. In this case, Greenleaf uses agential identity power over Marge, thereby controlling who can provide knowledge, and further denying Marge this capability. Greenleaf has failed to correct the irrational operation of identity power that distorts his credibility judgement. This suggests that testimonial responsibility requires a distinctly reflexive critical social awareness (2007, 91). In other words, the needed corrective anti-prejudicial virtue should be reflexive in structure, where the virtuous hearer recognizes both their identity and the interrelations between it and the identity of the person they are listening to. This further requires examining for the possible influence of prejudice in one’s judgments and then proceeding to fix or adjust the level of credibility accordingly. In this way, exhibiting this virtue of testimonial justice will involve neutralizing the impact of prejudice in the making of credibility judgements.

Fricker discusses several different ways this might be achieved (2007, 93-95). Usually, this will require an active corrective process, where self-reflective monitoring is needed to correct one’s judgments. While this active reflection is the default approach, it can also be accomplished through familiarity. On meeting someone for the first time, we might harbor negative attitudes against them given the way they speak or their social class. However, as we come to know this person and become friends, such attitudes disappear without any conscious reflection (for further examples, see 2007, 96). The changing circumstances surrounding the presence of prejudice in society over time may mean that our best hope in achieving the required reflexivity in judgement is through constant critical reflection. A further consequence of this fact is that possession of the virtue may always be partial. Acquiring the virtue of testimonial justice will involve a combination of spontaneity and ongoing critical alertness to the influence of prejudices, but even in the best of cases this will only be partial.

6. Hermeneutical Injustice

We now turn to a discussion of the other type of epistemic injustice described by Fricker, ‘hermeneutical injustice’, which is related in important ways to testimonial injustice, but is distinct and arguably more fundamental. Feminist philosophers have emphasized the way relations of power limit women’s ability to understand their own experiences. Seen from an epistemological perspective, this means that those in power have an unfair advantage in structuring our collective social understanding and knowledge. These issues of power and their connection of knowledge come increasingly to the fore with hermeneutical injustice.

Shared understandings and knowledge reflect the perspectives of different social groups. Relations of unequal power can distort these shared interpretive resources in ways that enable the powerful to make sense of their social experiences while those with less power cannot (2007, 148). Women collectively have had to overcome routine social interpretive habits and come up with exceptional interpretations of some of their confusing experiences together. This required them to develop resources to understand their experience that are largely implicit, or even absent from, the interpretive practices of their time. In the case of post-partum depression, for example, women were unable to understand their experience precisely because it was collectively ill-understood (2007, 149). In part this rests on social unfairness, one that results in a kind of structural inequality between men and women. This points to the possibility of a kind of epistemic injustice that may need to be overcome. Significant parts of a woman’s social experience may be downgraded or not taken seriously, with the result being a loss of self-understanding. Once again, individuals are wronged in their capacity as knowers resulting in the distinct type of epistemic injustice known as hermeneutical injustice.

Fricker locates such problematic experience within the ‘credibility economy’, which concerns the distribution of epistemic resources across a domain. In terms of epistemology, an uneven distribution of resources involving concepts, credibility, and knowledge, can lead to “hermeneutical marginalization” (2007, 153). A socially disadvantaged group can be blocked from access to knowledge, or access to communicating knowledge because of a gap in interpretive resources. This is especially so when these resources would help them understand the existence and nature of their marginalization. Such interpretive resources form part of our shared ‘social imagination’, concepts widely known and available for use in understanding ourselves and for communicating with others. They represent our shared tools of social interpretation and communication (see McKinnon 2016, 441).

This hermeneutical marginalization takes on an additional moral and political dimension since it indicates the subordination and exclusion from some practice that would be of value for the participant (2007, 153). This can impact a wide range of social experiences or perhaps only a certain area of experience. It can be also socially coerced. Given the complexity of social identities, one might be marginalized in one context (‘women’) but not in another (‘middle-class’) where one’s identity might determine level of participation. Marginalization can be an effect of material power (socio-economic background), or identity power, involving prejudicial stereotypes that present someone as unsuitable for a job. Moreover, this marginalization could be structural, or agent centered (consider the example of ageism among employers (2007, 154). What is negative about this form of marginalization is a structural prejudice that is present in our collective interpretive resources, and which is discriminatory (for examples see 2007, 155). Hermeneutical injustice can then be defined as “the injustice of having some significant area of one’s social experience obscured from collective understanding owing to a structural identity prejudice in the collective hermeneutical resource” (2007, 155).

Consider the further example of sexual harassment prior to its recognition as a serious social problem. Before being able to name, or categorize a variety of workplace behaviors, women were unable to understand their own experiences and the discomfort they felt in terms of harassment (2007, 149-150). This changed with the emergence of consciousness raising movements that enabled a better understanding of such experiences and their falling under the category of harassment. “Sexual harassment” as a concept was absent from our social imagination before this occurred. However, once this concept was available women were able to understand their experiences and communicate them to others. They were also in a position of increased power to limit and prevent them from happening. As a result, their hermeneutical marginalization was lessened, and in the process, one type of hermeneutical injustice was further minimized.

In the case of hermeneutical injustice, there is no agent; it is, as Fricker notes “purely structural” (2007,159). In addition, hermeneutical injustice may be further worsened through the testimonial injustice that can follow in its wake. In the case of women suffering from post-partum depression prior to its recognition as a serious medical condition, not only were they struggling with the structural interpretive gap that renders their experience ill understood and therefore difficult to communicate. But this can be worsened when they are not taken seriously due to gender prejudice in testimonial contexts with for example, doctors and husbands. Hermeneutical injustice can then be systematic, as members of marginalized groups are subject to an identity prejudice. Trying to explain their own poorly understood experience will receive a low credibility judgment because of the general difficulties associated with understanding it. If this is based on an identity prejudice, they are then doubly wronged (2007, 159). Here, the structural prejudice in our shared interpretive resources is coupled with an identity-prejudicial credibility judgement in our testimony with others (2007, 159-160).

7. The Wrong of Interpretive Injustice and the Virtue of Hermeneutical Justice

We have been witnessing the fact that in cases of hermeneutical injustice or what will also be referred to as ‘interpretive injustice’, there exists an asymmetrical cognitive disadvantage, where a collective hermeneutical gap impacts members of different groups in different ways. The doctor unable to diagnosis post-partum depression is not harmed, but the patient is. In cases of harassment, the harasser is not harmed, but the harassed are. This asymmetry results from a concrete, social and practical context that is influenced by a gap in our interpretive resources. Therefore, hermeneutical injustice is a kind of structural discrimination, where a collective gap places some group at a disadvantage that is discriminatory. In this section we consider the exact nature of the harm in cases of interpretive injustice and as was the case with testimonial injustice seek remedies in terms of virtue.

We can begin by considering the analogy of a welfare state with free healthcare but no dental care health plan (2007, 161-162). The social structure of the state provides general access to healthcare, a notable good. But the further lack of dental coverage leads to a gap in healthcare provisions that can be seen as discriminatory for those who lack the material means to pay for such coverage. Like the cases seen with hermeneutical injustice, some group is asymmetrically disadvantaged by a collective structural social lacuna. As a result, those unable to pay for dental coverage are unjustly harmed by the group gap in social services.

We can then appreciate that the primary harm of interpretive injustice is located in this situated hermeneutic inequality (2007, 162). It is useful to briefly compare this with the wrong associated with testimonial injustice. The primary harm common to both involves a prejudicial exclusion from participation in the spread of knowledge. We have seen further secondary harms revolving around practical consequences that can negatively impact everyday practical life (2007, 162-163). There are also secondary epistemic disadvantages concerning a loss of epistemic confidence (2007, 163). However, there remains a central difference between the primary harm seen in testimonial injustice and that found in cases of interpretive injustice injustice (168). The structural nature of the hermeneutical harm suggests that we need a new type of virtue to deal with hermeneutical injustice, something more than the virtue seen with testimonial justice. The virtue of testimonial justice secures the reliability of what is said without prejudice and can at times be achieved without reflective monitoring of prejudicial influence on one’s judgements (2007, 169). In the case of hermeneutical injustice, we must counteract a gap in the social environment that threatens not simply the reliability of what is said, but its very intelligibility. As a result, and unlike the case of testimonial injustice, the virtue must always be corrective in structure. What this means is that the virtue of hermeneutical justice must involve awareness (or alertness) to the possibility that there is a problem with someone communicating their experience when they are not the source of the problem.. Instead, it is due to a gap in the social resources available to communicate that experience, the key point being that the speaker is struggling with an objective problem, not a subjective one.

This critical awareness or sensitivity, that is, the reflexive awareness on the part of a hearer, highlights how they must be aware of the relationship between their social identity and that of the speaker and its influence on the intelligibility of what is being said (2007, 169). Both testimonial justice and hermeneutical justice share this reflexive awareness since it guards against types of identity prejudice. Furthermore, this reflexive awareness enables a correction in credibility judgements, where the lack of understanding of what is said led to a judgment of low credibility. However, in the case of hermeneutical justice, this involves not simply an assessment of whether the speaker is reliable but a further effort to recognize the truthfulness of what is said. In other words, in hermeneutical contexts, the responsible hearer makes a credibility judgment that is an assessment of the degree to which what is said ‘makes good sense’ that is, is a truthful interpretation of what is said: “The guiding ideal is that the degree of credibility is adjusted upwards to compensate for the cognitive and expressive handicap imposed on the hermeneutically marginalized speaker by the non-inclusive hermeneutical climate, by structural identity prejudice” (2007, 170). The hearer proceeds to minimize the way structural identity prejudice prevents the speaker from being understood. How would the virtuous hearer attempt to do this? With enough time, patience, careful attention, and understanding of the possible existence of epistemic injustice, the hearer can attempt to provide a more inclusive interpretive environment. This might obviously include engaging in a more extended, engaged discussion and a commitment to the kind of ‘epistemic humility’ toward interpretation needed to create this more inclusive setting.

What else might be involved in this more proactive, more socially aware kind of listening, where one is attentive both to what is said and what is not said? The lack of shared social experience can make this difficult. The responsible hearer needs to seek out other supporting evidence, and grounds for doubt concerning the reliability of what is said. There is an ongoing need to look for further evidence. Often there may not be enough time, requiring that one reserve judgement and keep an open mind to the credibility of testimony. The aim or end of the virtue is to neutralize the impact of the structural identity prejudice on one’s credibility judgment. The ultimate end or final aim may sometimes be understanding which falls more on the intellectual side. Other times the aim is justice and ethical virtue reflected in our actions and practices. Sometimes it may be both. Fricker emphasizes that the practical context will decide the precise nature of the end pursued.

8. Extensions and Challenges

There have been many further extensions of these ideas, both in terms of additional clarifications of the nature of epistemic injustice and its further application in the fields of education, healthcare, law, science, religion and elsewhere. This concluding section briefly discusses three areas. First, the possibility of credibility excess as a form of epistemic injustice. Second, institutional forms of epistemic injustice and their possible remedies. Lastly, the possible scope and sources of hermeneutical injustice.

We earlier saw Fricker stress credibility deficit as the core case of epistemic injustice. Many commentators have stressed the need to recognize instances of credibility excess as leading to related types of epistemic injustice and harm (Davis 2016; Medina 2011). For example, Davis has argued that positive prejudicial judgments and the inflated credibility that they engender leads to epistemic harm. The idea that Asians are all good at mathematics, or all African Americans good at sports are two familiar examples. In these and related cases, Davis points to the possibility of identity-prejudicial credibility excess, noting that such credibility excess includes an ethically flawed affective investment, where this involves a marked inability to recognize the individuality of members of the same social group (2016, 487-488). But briefly, the harm of this credibility excess involves the speaker’s subjectivity being limited by other dominant hearers, in terms of being allowed to contribute to the conversation only in ways that are viewed as distinct and unique as this is captured in the positive stereotype used (2016, 490). In order to counter this, Davis suggests that the reflexive corrective virtue suggested by Fricker include a greater expansive understanding of the larger epistemic landscape where discussion takes place (for details see 2016, 493-496).

Related ideas are discussed by Anderson, who argues that the existence of structural, institutional forms of epistemic injustice requires greater emphasis on the need for structural remedies (2012). Fricker’s exclusive use of individual epistemic virtues as remedies fails to address the kinds of structural injustices that may have locally innocent (non-prejudicial) causes. Structural causes of group-based credibility deficits may include what Anderson describes as ethnocentrism and a ‘shared reality bias’ (2012, 169-170). Ethnocentrism is described as bias in favor of groups to which one belongs and while morally innocent and epistemically useful when directed inward, can transmit structural injustice from one setting to another. If different groups engaged in inquiry are segregated based on their social identities, this may then lead to systematic unjust group inequalities, where, for example, an advantaged group disregards the testimony of a less advantaged group. This would serve to reinforce the epistemic disadvantages of this group and damage the epistemic standing of their members. In such cases, ethnocentrism causes a form a structural testimonial injustice.

The shared reality bias is a tendency of individuals who interact frequently to converge on their perspectives and judgments about the world. Again, such a bias is epistemically useful for individuals engaged in joint inquiry. However, when groups of inquirers are segregated along the same lines that define group inequalities, the shared reality bias will tend to insulate members of advantaged groups from the perspectives of the systematically disadvantaged. Members of the advantaged group will be unable to make sense of the perspective of those in the disadvantaged group. This is because the interpretive resources available have been developed for members of the advantaged group and their experiences. Such resources remain inadequate for understanding the experiences of those from whom they are isolated in the other disadvantaged group.

Anderson further notes that this shared reality bias, when coupled with inequality-grounding group segregation, is a cause of hermeneutical injustice (2012, 170). This epistemic injustice may in turn cause a structural testimonial injustice. This account of hermeneutical injustice allows that marginalized communities may succeed in developing coherent accounts of their own experience, something that Fricker was, perhaps, slow to appreciate. They may nevertheless suffer from hermeneutical injustice in that the more advantaged are unable to understand them. However, it is another case of a transactionally innocent cognitive bias that can lead to the spread of a structural injustice into new areas.

Anderson concludes that epistemic virtue is needed at both individual and structural levels. In the cases of ethnocentrism and the shared reality bias, group segregation along lines of social inequality is the key structural feature that turns innocent, if cognitively biased, epistemic transactions into vectors of epistemic injustice. If group segregation is the structural backdrop to this structural type of epistemic injustice, then Anderson proposes that greater group integration is a structural remedy, and therefore a virtue of epistemic institutions (institutions concerned with the distribution of knowledge, such as educational or scientific communities) (2012, 171-172).

The idea that marginalized groups suffering from hermeneutical injustice can still develop an understanding of their own experience is further explored by Goetze (2018). He frames this central point in terms of the concept of ‘hermeneutical dissent’, where marginalized groups have developed their own interpretive tools for understanding their experiences. He first explains how to view our collective interpretative resources in order to accommodate such dissent and then further shows how this results in interpretative injustice and harm. By his account, the primary harm of hermeneutical injustice occurs when a subject has a distinctive and important social experience that lacks intelligibility at a crucial moment (2018, 79). This intelligibility may be cognitive, when they fail to possess the tools needed to sense their experience, or communicative, when they are unable to communicate their understanding to others. On the basis of this disjunctive characterization of the primary harm found in hermeneutical injustice, Goetze is able to offer a further taxonomy of the various species of such injustice in terms of where the gap in our collective hermeneutical resources appears (for details see 2018, 80-85). Lastly, he shows how this impacts our understanding of epistemic justice and virtue in such cases. As we have seen, he too recommends that the virtuous hearer exhibit epistemic humility in terms of their interpretative resources, and further to recognize the need for a more expansive view of our epistemic environment, where this may include the kind of social integration championed by Anderson (2018, 86-87).

9. References and Further Reading

The following list highlights several classical treatments and some important extensions. For an extensive bibliography of earlier work, see the article on epistemic injustice in the Oxford Bibliographies Online. For two anthologies that treat a number of central themes and topics, see the Routledge Handbook of Epistemic Injustice, edited by Ian James Kidd, José Medina, and Gaile Pohlhaus, 2017 and Overcoming Epistemic Injustice, edited by Benjamin R. Sherman and Stacey Goguen, Rowman and Littlefield International, 2019.

Anderson, Elizabeth. (2012). Epistemic Justice as a Virtue of Social Institutions. Social Epistemology 26.2: 163-173.
Focuses on institutional injustice and wonders what kind of remedies are required to counter this structural form of epistemic injustice.
Arpaly, Nomy. (2003). Unprincipled Virtue: An Inquiry into Moral Agency. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Discusses the difference between a non-culpable mistake and prejudice through the Solomon example.
Begby, Endre. (2021). Prejudice: A Study in Non-Ideal Epistemology. Oxford University Press.
An important study that discusses how our epistemic circumstances may result in prejudicial beliefs that are not morally blameworthy. Provides a contrasting position on the Solomon case discussed by Arpaly 2003, and Fricker 2007.
Davis, Emmalon. 2016. Typecasts, Tokens, and Spokespersons: A Case for Credibility Excess as Testimonial Injustice. Hypatia vol. 31: (3): 485-501.
Convincingly argues that for many minority groups, credibility excess leads to serious types of epistemic injustice.
Doan, Michael D. (2018). Resisting Structural Epistemic Injustice. Feminist Philosophy Quarterly 4 (4).
A further consideration of institutional forms of epistemic injustice focusing on struggles that are political.
Dotson, Kristie (2012). ‘A Cautionary Tale: On Limiting Epistemic Oppression’ Frontiers Vol. 33 Issue 1; pp. 24-47.
Presents a third type of epistemic injustice: contributory injustice. Here, a hearer is willfully insensitive to the interpretive resources used by a speaker thereby compromising their epistemic agency.
Freedman, Karyn L. (2020). The Epistemic Significance of #MeToo. Feminist Philosophy Quarterly 6 (2). Article 2.
Argues for the epistemic value of #MeToo testimony for survivors as hearers, as tellers, and for society at large.
Fricker, Miranda (2007) Epistemic Injustice: Power and The Ethics of Knowing (Oxford University Press)
Classic presentation of two main kinds of epistemic injustice: ‘testimonial injustice’ and ‘hermeneutical injustice’. Further offers the virtues of ‘testimonial justice’ and ‘hermeneutical justice’ as possible remedies.
Fricker, Miranda (2012). ‘Silence and Institutional Prejudice’, in Sharon Crasnow and Anita Superson eds. Out From the Shadows: Analytical Feminist Contributions to Traditional Philosophy (Oxford University Press).
Traces the development of Fricker’s interest in epistemic injustice and argues for the importance of institutional virtues of epistemic justice.
Fricker, Miranda (2013). ‘Epistemic Justice as a Condition of Political Freedom’ Synthese Vol. 190, Issue 7; pp. 1317-332.
Extends the idea of epistemic injustice into the political domain. Argues that institutions should cultivate institutional virtues of epistemic justice in order to prevent dominating citizens by denying them resources to question abuses of power.
Goetze, Trystan S. (2018). Hermeneutical Dissent and the Species of Hermeneutical Injustice. Hypatia 33 (1):73-90.
Provides a helpful taxonomy of the sources and scope of hermeneutical injustice through a discussion of the possibility of interpretive dissent.
Jackson, Debra L. (2018). “Me Too”: Epistemic Injustice and the Struggle for Recognition. Feminist Philosophy Quarterly 4 (4). Article 7.
Examines the lack of recognition found in forms of epistemic injustice experienced by victims of sexual harassment and assault.
Jenkins, Katharine (2017). Rape Myths and Domestic Abuse Myths as Hermeneutical Injustices. Journal of Applied Philosophy 34 (2):191-205.
Examines the way myths about rape and domestic abuse lead to distinctive types of interpretive injustice.
Lippmann, Walter. (1965). Public Opinion. New York: Free Press. First published in 1922.
Famous study that examines the use of stereotypes in the framing of public opinion.
Lukes, Steven. (1974). Power: A Radical View. London: Macmillan.
Classic analysis of power and its uses.
McConkey, Jane (2004). ‘Knowledge and Acknowledgement: ‘“Epistemic Injustice” as a Problem of Recognition’, Politics Vol. 24, No. 3; 198-205.
Explores testimonial injustice as involving a failure of recognition.
McKinnon, Rachel. (2016). Epistemic Injustice, Philosophy Compass 11/8: 437–446.
A useful overview that locates epistemic injustice within the epistemology of testimony.
Medina, José. (2011). ‘The Relevance of Credibility Excess in a Proportional view of Epistemic Injustice: Differential Epistemic Authority and the Social Imaginary’, Social Epistemology Vol. 25, No. 1; pp. 15-35.
Argues that prejudicial credibility excess should be seen as a kind of epistemic injustice.
Pohlhaus, Gaile (2014). ‘Discerning the Primary Epistemic Harm in Cases of Testimonial Injustice’, Social Epistemology, 28(2); pp. 99-114.
Argues that the harm of testimonial injustice is not a kind of epistemic objectification as in Fricker’s work but should be drawn in terms of the subject-other relation, as seen in the work of Ann Cahill and Simone de Beauvoir.
Pohlhaus Jr, Gaile (2012). ‘Relational Knowing and Epistemic Injustice: Toward a Theory of Willful Hermeneutical Ignorance’, Hypatia: A Journal of Feminist Philosophy, Vol. 27, Issue 4; pp. 715-735.
Argues that “willful hermeneutical ignorance” should be considered a third type of epistemic injustice.
Twain, Mark. (1998). The Adventures of Tom Sawyer, New York: Dover Publications. First published 1876.
Classic American tale introducing Huckleberry Finn.
Yap, Audrey S. (2017). “Credibility Excess and the Social Imaginary in Cases of Sexual Assault.” Feminist Philosophy Quarterly 3, (4). Article 1
Considers the epistemic harms of credibility excess through application to the case of sexual assault.

Author Information

Rob Sinclair
Email: sinclair@soka.ac.jp
Soka University
Japan

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy