Henri Bergson (1859-1941)
Henri Bergson was one of the most influential philosophers of the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries. His philosophy, centred on the concept of duration and praising intuition as a method of philosophical inquiry, was recognised across the world. His fame was so great that his visit to Columbia University is reputed to have caused the first ever traffic jam on Broadway.
The originality of his thought explains much of this popularity. Bergson’s philosophy stood in contrast both to the Kantian tradition and Comtean positivism, and although it shared affinities with both French spiritualism and Anglo-Saxon pragmatism, it did not coincide fully with either. Indeed, Bergson conceived his philosophy in opposition to traditional philosophical movements and their academic quarrels, which he believed stemmed from the misstatement of problems—that is, from posing them in terms of space rather than time, with a quantitative rather than qualitative approach.
The appeal of his philosophy, often referred to as a “philosophy of life”, also lay in its timeliness. Bergson emphasised the reality of duration just as Einstein was formulating the theory of relativity (leading to their famous debate in 1922); he wrote of creative evolution at a time when controversies over Darwinism were at their height; and he warned against societies’ tendencies towards closure on the eve of the Second World War.
This international prestige brought the man—often described as reserved and bashful—the Nobel Prize in Literature (1927) and led the French government to entrust him with diplomatic responsibilities, not least efforts to persuade Woodrow Wilson to secure American involvement in the First World War.
A historical and philosophical figure whose influence extended from French existentialists to Chinese nationalists, Bergson nevertheless experienced a mixed reception in the twentieth century. After the Second World War, his thought was increasingly relegated to the margins, if not to oblivion. However, the early twenty-first century witnessed a significant revival of interest in his work, as his central concepts gained new resonance in the light of scientific discoveries, political developments, and emerging ecological concerns.
Table of Contents
1. Life and Works
a. Early Years
Henri Louis Bergson was born in Paris on 18 October 1859, to a Polish father and an English mother. His father, Michal Bergson, was born in Warsaw into a wealthy merchant family belonging to the Hasidic Jewish community. The family’s prestige granted them certain rights normally denied to Jews in Poland, notably the right to reside in Warsaw and to wear traditional Jewish dress. When Michal’s father died, only one son inherited this privilege, forcing Michal to leave Warsaw. At the age of twenty, he moved to Germany to pursue musical studies and travelled across Europe before settling in Paris, where he led a fluctuating musical career without ever quite achieving recognition. In Paris, he met Kate Levinson, an English Jew of Irish descent, whom he married in 1856. Kate, born in England and the daughter of a Yorkshire doctor, managed the household and spoke English with their seven children—so that Bergson grew up completely bilingual. In 1863, the family moved to Switzerland, as Michal had obtained a position at the Geneva Conservatory. Four years later, however, he resigned and returned to Paris, before moving his family once again, this time to London—without Henri.
From an early age, Henri Bergson stood out for his intellectual gifts. He received several scholarships to support his education, including one from the French government, which enabled him to enrol in 1868 at one of the best secondary schools in France, the Lycée Condorcet (then the Lycée Bonaparte) in Paris. This prompted his family to leave him in Paris when they moved to London. Bergson was a brilliant student, winning numerous awards in a variety of subjects. He was noticed by his mathematics teacher, Adolphe Desboves, after successfully solving Pascal’s problem of the three circles. Yet, despite this talent, he decided to pursue philosophy (“you could have been a mathematician”, Desboves reportedly told him, “you will be a mere a philosopher”). Bergson entered the École Normale Supérieure in 1878. Although French philosophy at the time was largely shaped by spiritualism—a school of thought that regarded consciousness as distinct from matter and possibly as primary—Bergson was drawn to the evolutionist ideas of the British philosopher Herbert Spencer, who proposed a mechanistic interpretation of the universe.
After graduating from the École, Bergson first taught in Angers (1881-1883), then for five years in Clermont-Ferrand. During these years, he worked both on classical authors and on the development of his own philosophy. In 1884, he published a selection of Lucretius’s works with an accompanying critical study. More importantly, during this period he wrote both of his doctoral theses in full: Quid Aristoteles de loco senserit and Time and Free Will. The latter investigates how freedom of the will is possible if our mental states are determined by physical causes. According to Bergson, this is a badly stated problem, since consciousness is not a material and spatial reality governed by determinism, but a psychological one characterised by duration—that is, by maturation, generating heterogeneity and unpredictability. Interested in Zeno’s paradoxes, Bergson, who initially aspired to become a philosopher of science in the footsteps of Spencer, discovered that scientific definitions of time had no real bearing on the passage of time itself, in its lived, qualitative dimension. He later recounted this discovery to his disciple Jacques Chevalier:
I was then steeped in mathematicism and mechanism. The predominant influence on my mind was that of Spencer, and I dreamed of extending the mechanistic explanation to the entire universe, only more precisely and closely defined. […] However, while I approached the world as a mathematician, as a mechanist, […] reality resisted me: reality, or rather one reality, time, true duration, which I was unable to reduce, revealed itself. Everything that I had previously neglected as secondary became essential.
While writing his thesis, Bergson became interested in psychic phenomena, particularly telepathy and hypnosis. In collaboration with the scientist André Robinet, he conducted experiments that led to the publication of his first academic article in the Revue philosophique de la France et de l’étranger, in 1886. In this paper, Bergson and Robinet put forward the hypothesis that hypnosis could enhance perceptual abilities, producing a form of hyperaesthesia. However, this paper provoked a rebuke from the renowned philosopher Alphonse Darlu, who considered these experiments philosophically dangerous. Following this episode, Bergson continued to take an interest in psychical research (also known as parapsychology or metapsychics) throughout his career, though he did so discreetly, remaining extremely cautious in his statements and publishing little on controversial subjects that bordered on the supernatural. In 1901, he joined the Groupe d’études des phénomènes psychiques, briefly chairing the commission investigating the physical medium Eusapia Palladino. He also served as President of the Society for Psychical Research in 1913. The philosopher Bertrand Méheust later described Bergson’s involvement in psychical research as “an open secret.”
In 1889, Bergson defended his two theses, then returned to Paris, where he first taught at the Collège Rollin and later at the prestigious Lycée Henri-IV. In 1892, he married Louise Neuburger, a first cousin of Jeanne Weil—Marcel Proust’s mother—with Proust himself attending the ceremony as a groomsman. Their only child, Jeanne, was born deaf, yet she nevertheless became a celebrated painter and sculptor, studying under Bourdelle. Although Bergson was twice denied a position at the Sorbonne (then dominated by materialist currents), the publication of Matter and Memory (1896) brought him recognition in philosophical circles and secured him a chair at the Collège de France.
b. The Collège de France and Bergson’s Glory
It was at this prestigious institution that Bergson experienced his years of greatest fame, both through his teaching and his writings. Unlike most higher education institutions, the Collège de France offers free access to its lectures, which are open to everyone and require no registration. Bergson’s courses soon became immensely popular, a success reinforced by the reception of his writings—Laughter (1900) and “Introduction to Metaphysics” (1903). The latter, in particular, was translated into many languages and exerted a major influence on American pragmatists, especially William James. In this essay, Bergson developed the idea of intuition as a fundamental methodological tool of philosophy—the only intellectual faculty capable of grasping reality itself.
The enthusiasm for Bergson’s lectures at the time was unprecedented: all of Paris flocked to hear him, and crowds reportedly fought for entrance at the doors of the Collège de France. In 1901, he was elected to the Académie des Sciences Morales et Politiques, and in 1902 he received the Légion d’honneur. But it was above all the publication of Creative Evolution (1907) that cemented his fame—while also provoking controversy, leading the Church, opposed to the idea of evolution, to place his works on the Index. In this book, Bergson addressed the debates surrounding evolutionism and defended a non-mechanistic view of evolution, grounded in the idea of life’s inherent creativity. In 1911, he delivered a series of lectures in England, first in London and then in Oxford. Two years later, he was invited to New York to give a series of lectures at Columbia University—so well attended that they were said to have caused the first traffic jam on Broadway. The following year, he lectured in Edinburgh, Scotland.
Bergson’s extraordinary popularity—often referred to as “Bergsonmania”—nevertheless drew criticism. It was taken by some as evidence of the vagueness, even the frivolity, of his philosophy. His audience, largely composed of women, was reputed to be seduced by his supposed irrationalism and lack of rigour. The bergsoniennes were portrayed as socialites or snobinettes, enthralled by what critics saw as a superficial philosophy. Bergson also became the target of a virulent anti-Semitic campaign led by Action française. None of this, however, prevented his election to the prestigious Académie française in 1914. That same year, he requested to be relieved of his teaching duties at the Collège de France, marking the end of his public teaching career.
c. World War I: Bergson, the Diplomat
When the First World War broke out in 1914, Bergson —who had previously remained discreet on political matters, his silence during the Dreyfus Affair being noted by many commentators—became increasingly involved in public life. At the outset of the war, he delivered several patriotic speeches, even describing the conflict as a struggle of civilisation against barbarism in an address to the Académie des Sciences Morales et Politiques. Drawing on ideas developed in Creative Evolution, he defended, in an article published in Le Bulletin des Armées, the moral strength of France, which, he wrote, “seeks outside itself, above itself, a principle of life and renewal.”
Bergson’s international reputation, together with his bilingualism, led the French government to entrust him with various diplomatic missions. He was sent, along with other intellectuals, to Spain to promote French intellectual life and to establish contacts with influential figures likely to support the Allied cause. Among these missions, the most notable one took him to the United States in 1917. Officially, he was there to give lectures, but in fact he had been dispatched by the Minister of Foreign Affairs, Aristide Briand, to meet President Woodrow Wilson and persuade him to join the war on the side of the Allies, appealing in particular to the ideal of the League of Nations. He was received at the White House on 18 February. Although Bergson himself did not believe he had played a decisive role in Wilson’s decision to ask Congress for a declaration of war against Germany in April 1917, members of Wilson’s inner circle later suggested that Bergson’s influence had been greater than he thought. He returned to the United States in May 1918, this time in an unsuccessful attempt to persuade Wilson to open a second front in the East and to support the Czechoslovak Legion. After the war, Bergson continued to play a diplomatic role through the League of Nations and became the first president of the International Committee on Intellectual Cooperation, a position he resigned in 1925.
d. Debating with Einstein
At the end of the war, Bergson published Mind-Energy (1919), a collection of essays bringing together psychological and metaphysical reflections, notably on the relationship between soul and body. By this time, the “Bergsonmania” of the pre-war years had begun to fade, which can be explained by a number of factors. First, Bergson published less regularly. Second, having resigned from his position at the Collège de France, he had lost some of the aura he had acquired through his public speaking. Finally, and more broadly, his philosophy now appeared increasingly out of step with the post-war intellectual climate.
Although Bergson published less, he did not abandon philosophy for politics. On the contrary, during these years he took a keen interest in Albert Einstein’s theory of relativity and sought to demonstrate its compatibility with his own ideas in Duration and Simultaneity (1922). On 6 April 1922, at a meeting of the Société française de philosophie, Bergson had the opportunity to debate directly with Einstein, who was in Paris to deliver a series of lectures. Pressed by the audience, Bergson asked Einstein about the relationship between mathematical time (as characterised by relativity) and the real time that lies beyond mathematical symbolisation—in other words, the time people actually experience. Bergson argued that the connection between lived duration and measured time could be understood through simultaneity, conceived as the “intersection of time and space.” He wondered whether there might exist an absolute simultaneity (rather than merely local ones, as in the theory of relativity) referring to an absolute time and, consequently, to the becoming of the universe. Einstein dismissed the question, asserting that “the time of the philosophers does not exist.”
This exchange contributed to Bergson’s discredit among scientists, who accused him of misunderstanding relativity, to the point that Bergson forbade the reprinting of Duration and Simultaneity and withdrew from the debate altogether. The dispute with Einstein left a lasting mark on his reputation among scientists. Over the course of the twentieth century, the rise of neo-Darwinism—criticised in Creative Evolution—and developments in genetics further reinforced the perception that Bergson’s philosophy had become obsolete within the scientific community.
e. Later Years and World War II
The final years of Henri Bergson’s life were marked by illness. From 1925 onwards, he suffered from rheumatoid arthritis, a painful condition that progressively immobilised him and forced him to withdraw from public life. When he received the Nobel Prize in 1928, he had already been relegated to the margins of public attention. Far from the transgressive philosopher he had been twenty years earlier, he was portrayed by Georges Politzer as a bourgeois conservative, placing his philosophy at the service of the government and, in particular, of the war effort.
Although Bergson seldom left his home, he continued to work on what would become his last major work, The Two Sources of Morality and Religion, published in 1932—twenty-five years after his previous great success. The book examined the tendencies towards closure and isolation that characterise societies, moral systems, and religions. Despite Bergson’s waning influence, The Two Sources of Morality and Religion rekindled vigorous debate. In 1934, he also published The Creative Mind, a collection of essays that included “Introduction to Metaphysics” and is often regarded as the methodological gateway to his philosophy.
In 1940, when the Germans invaded France, Bergson was in Dax undergoing medical treatment. He nonetheless returned to Paris, where he was living when the Vichy government promulgated the Statut des Juifs, which, among other restrictions, excluded Jews from public office. Although the government offered him an exemption from this statute, Bergson refused the privilege. At the end of 1940, he personally queued to register as Jewish. A few weeks later, on 4 January 1941, Bergson died of pneumonia at his home in the 16th arrondissement of Paris. Although Bergson never converted—he reportedly refused conversion, so as not to provide ammunition to the growing number of anti-Semites in the late 1930s—a Catholic priest attended him on his deathbed, as Bergson seemed to have undergone an intellectual conversion. In his will, he requested that all his unpublished writings be destroyed, a wish his wife and daughter dutifully fulfilled (rumour has it that among the destroyed papers was a semi-finished manuscript).
2. Philosophy
“A philosopher worthy of the name has never said more than a single thing: and even then it is something he has tried to say, rather than actually said” (The Creative Mind). For Bergson, this “single thing” is the intuition of duration—that is, of time understood as maturation, as qualitative development, and as fundamentally distinct from quantitative, measurable, or “spatialised” time—the time of science. Duration, specific to consciousness but also to life, is characterised by a multiplicity that is not an addition of elements but a qualitative progression. In other words, consciousness, as well as life, because they are temporal, are not things or aggregates of discrete elements: they are “processual”.
It is on the basis of this intuition of duration that Bergson re-examines the problem of freedom in Time and Free Will. For him, free will ceases to be problematic once the creativity inherent in the duration of consciousness is acknowledged. Bergson thus distinguishes between the causation characteristic of the material realm and that of enduring processes, marked by unpredictability. This distinction reappears in Laughter: laughter, according to Bergson, is a response to the comic, where mechanical rigidity appears incompatible with the fluidity of the living. This same contrast between duration and space, or between the intensive and the extensive, also underlies Bergson’s account of the relationship between mind and matter in Matter and Memory. In Creative Evolution, he extends the distinction to biology: since the categories used by our intelligence are spatial, they can grasp material or mechanical causality but not the duration specific to living beings. They can thus explain physical and chemical phenomena, but not development or evolution—what is properly biological. The intuition of duration therefore articulates the whole of Bergson’s philosophy; it also structures his method.
Because Bergson’s focus is on duration—that is, on time that cannot be measured and thus eludes analysis—the dominant faculty cannot be analytical intelligence but must instead be philosophical intuition. Nevertheless, it would be wrong to see Bergson as an irrational thinker detached from science. On the contrary, one of the distinctive features of his philosophy is its continuous dialogue with science. In Time and Free Will and Matter and Memory, Bergson analyses contemporary psychopathology; in Creative Evolution, he examines biological theories in detail, including both medical and evolutionary science; and in The Two Sources of Morality and Religion, he turns to sociology and the history of religions. According to Bergson, philosophy must be constructed so as to withstand the test of science, but science itself also advances and corrects its course through philosophy. Bergson illustrates this mutual dependence with the image of the aviator and the diver, representing the philosopher and the scientist respectively. If the diver “feels out the wreck on the sea floor,” it is because the aviator “has pointed [it] out from the air” (The Creative Mind). Only philosophical intuition can see for the mere purpose of seeing and thus locate the wreck; intelligence is oriented only towards what is useful for action. Admittedly, the aviator can only take off by relying on the data gathered by the diver: it is by drawing on scientific discoveries that philosophical questions arise, suggesting where to look. In return, it will be “immersed in the conceptual environment” produced by philosophy that science will “verify from point to point, by contact, analytically, what had been the subject of a synthetic and supra-intellectual vision.” Hence, for Bergson, science and philosophy can only advance hand in hand.
a. Duration and the Infirmity of Intelligence
The originality of Bergsonian philosophy lies less in its topics than in their treatment. Bergson revisits traditional philosophical problems—free will, the relationship between mind and body, and the relation between life and matter—but approaches them in an innovative way, through the intuition of duration. For Bergson, duration is not “one moment replacing another,” but “the continuous progress of the past, which gnaws into the future and which swells as it advances.” This progress is most striking within consciousness itself. It is first and foremost within oneself that one experiences duration as maturation. Consciousness cannot therefore be conceived as a mere juxtaposition of mental states: it is the continuous growth of a personality, and free action is that which expresses the continuity of this inner development. Nevertheless, Bergson’s notion of duration is not confined to a purely inner feeling. Although duration is first experienced within one’ own consciousness, it is not merely subjective, nor is it unique to human awareness. According to Bergson, duration is what weaves together the entire fabric of reality, across a plurality of rhythms—from the inertia of matter to the creative intensity of life and artistic invention.
When duration approaches inertia, as in material or inorganic realities, it can adequately be grasped by our spatial, intellectual schemas, which rely on generality and repetition. But certain realities are characterised by creative duration, as is the case with vital phenomena, and among them, consciousness. While consciousness is the ratio cognoscendi of life’s duration, life is the ratio essendi of consciousness’s duration: individual consciousness is but a singularisation of life’s creative flow. For these realities, which are characterised by creative duration, to deny unpredictability—that is, to deny that there is more in the present than in the past—is to miss precisely what is essential. Such phenomena cannot be analysed in terms of deterministic causes and effects that follow one another discretely. Indeed, in enduring realities, moments cannot be counted like spatial elements. When one distinguishes moments, one measures time, thereby obliterating duration: time is mistaken for space. Science, Bergson argues, deals only with abstract time, which is incommensurable with real duration. It projects time into an ideal, homogeneous space. At an instant t1, objects are in position or state p1. At t2, they are in p2. These instants can be juxtaposed along a line. An indefinite number of moments tₙ can be added between t₁ and t₂, yet the very continuity of time—its passage—is not grasped. “The abstract time t attributed by science to a material object or to an isolated system consists only in a certain number of simultaneities or more generally of correspondences,” but “with the “intervals between the correspondences, […] we are never concerned when dealing with inert matter.” (Creative Evolution).
b. A New Method
Intelligence, which is adequate for understanding matter, cannot properly comprehend realities for which duration is creative. Bergson’s critique of intelligence rests on two arguments: one genealogical and one epistemological.
The genealogical argument holds that intelligence, as a biological faculty formed in the course of evolution, has a specific biological function: to assist action by providing a better grasp of material conditions. More precisely, intelligence is the faculty of Homo faber—the maker of tools, whether material or conceptual. Homo faber is, in fact, also Homo sapiens, for Homo sapiens is born from the reflection of Homo faber upon his own production (Creative Evolution). To manufacture is to arrange means for ends; it implies, therefore, the ability to anticipate and to reduce unpredictability. The ideas developed by intelligence are thus instrumental ones, illuminating practice—that is, the human relation to matter, understood as an effort to master it—by erasing the unpredictable (and therefore creative) dimension of reality.
To this genealogical argument Bergson adds an epistemological argument, developed in “Introduction to Metaphysics.” Since intelligence is designed to serve the faculty of action in its capacity to dominate matter and to anticipate its transformations, it operates through a process of fixation: it substitutes stability for mobility, juxtaposition for succession. In other words, intelligence proceeds by generalisation—that is, by (1) retaining similarities (isolating what resembles the past), (2) extracting identities in order to apply the principle that the same remains the same, and (3) producing predictions on the assumption that the future will resemble the present. Intelligence can clearly represent only the static and the discontinuous, and the resulting science can “work only on what is supposed to repeat itself—that is to say, on what is withdrawn, by hypothesis, from the action of real time” (Creative Evolution). Science thus produces mechanistic (deterministic) explanations, which treat the future (like the past) as calculable from the present, implying that everything is already given, virtually present, in an imaginary, homogenous space (that is, spatialised time).
Duration, far removed from the fixed substances of traditional ontology, requires concepts different from the static ones used by science; it requires fluid concepts—that is, concepts with multiple characterisations, adapted to the elasticity of their object, thus capable of transcending the limits of scientific symbolisation. Such concepts cannot be discovered through traditional analytical intelligence. Their discovery demands an even more intense rational effort, one proceeding from intelligence’s reflection upon itself: by recognising its own limits, intelligence detaches itself from symbols in order to retrieve reality itself. This transformed and expanded intelligence, capable of following the inner movement of things—that is, of touching reality directly—is what Bergson calls philosophical intuition.
Bergsonian intuition is not a mystical or irrational faculty. If Bergson speaks of fluid concepts, it is because they remain concepts. They can be synthesised by phrases such as “duration,” “personality,” and “élan vital,” But they are fluid: these expressions, though apparently fixed, evoke qualitative differences that can be expressed through a multiplicity of images. This multiplicity renders mobile what the unity of the image would freeze. Thus, in Time and Free Will, Bergson invites contemplation on the continuity of the self as a flow, a thread rolled up, the insensible degradation of the nuances of a light spectrum, the lengthening of an elastic band, the tension and relaxation of a spring. The plurality of images has a cathartic value: it calls for a state of mind, an effort that frees the thinker from the rigidity of traditional concepts. This flexibility does not, however, exclude clarity, but its clarity is of a special kind. It is not the analytical clarity of mathematical proofs, which demonstrate known ideas in a novel order, but the clarity of radically new ideas, which are clear not so much in themselves as in what they allow one to understand. By illuminating the reality to which they refer and by enabling the resolution of seemingly insoluble problems, new ideas in turn illuminate themselves—their apparent obscurity being due only to their fundamentally innovative nature.
It is by conceiving of duration as the primary reality and by using intuition as a method that Bergson developed his other philosophical concepts.
c. Consciousness and Free Will
With the intuition of duration, Bergson reformulates the problem of free will. He inherits this problem from a long philosophical tradition, the most radical expression of which appears in Kant’s third antinomy of pure reason: how can the determinism of phenomena be reconciled with freedom, which appears to contradict natural law? The radical nature of this contradiction led some to posit determinism even within consciousness itself: mental states, they claimed, were caused by preceding ones according to laws of association—a view defended in particular by John Stuart Mill. At the turn of the twentieth century, the problem took on a new form with the rise of experimental psychology, shaped by the work of Gustav Theodor Fechner, Joseph Delbœuf, and Théodule Ribot. Experimental psychology sought to establish psychophysical laws, hypothesising a psychological determinism analogous to the physiological determinism formulated by Claude Bernard. The question thus became: how can humans be free if their mental states are determined by physical causes?
Bergson refuted these approaches to the problem of free will by showing that the opposition between freedom and determinism is only apparent. It stems, he argues, from “a previous confusion of duration with extensity, of succession with simultaneity, of quality with quantity” (Time and Free Will). This confusion originates in human intelligence, which can think only in terms of space, and in its auxiliary, language, which forces people to freeze and generalise their mental life through words—that is, through symbols. By criticising this confusion and revealing the temporal nature of consciousness, Bergson sought to resolve the problem of free will. He affirmed the reality of freedom not merely by opposing deterministic conceptions, but by showing that both determinists and their opponents misunderstood what freedom actually means.
To resolve this problem, Bergson proposes that consciousness should not be conceived as a sum of isolated states but as a process that unfolds over time, characterised by the interpenetration of its so-called “states.” He distinguishes between two kinds of multiplicity. Quantitative multiplicity consists of countable units that can be juxtaposed in an ideal, homogeneous space. This numerical and spatial multiplicity belongs to material objects, which can be both numbered and divided infinitely for the purposes of calculation. Mental states, however, cannot be counted in this way: they flow and interpenetrate; they cannot be completely separated. Their multiplicity is therefore qualitative rather than quantitative and can only be apprehended in duration. This multiplicity is also uncountable: as soon as one tries to distinguish parts within it, one no longer grasps the temporal reality of consciousness but instead projects it into a homogeneous and simultaneous medium—that is, into space. Consciousness and the personality that results from its maturation are temporal realities, and the free act is the one expressing this personality. Nevertheless, owing to humanity’s intelligence and language, there also exists a superficial self, shaped by the tendency to spatialise experience, which leads people to treat their mental states as things in space.
Freedom, therefore, admits of degrees. According to Bergson, the more an act is identified with the fundamental self, the freer it is: “we are free when our acts spring from our whole personality, when they express it, when they have that indefinable resemblance to it which one sometimes finds between the artist and his work” (Time and Free Will).
d. The Duration of Consciousness, the Duration of Matter
Bergson’s temporal understanding of consciousness led him to revisit the mind-body problem in terms of duration. Each consciousness is characterised by its own duration, whose rhythm depends on the individual’s (biological) engagement in action. Consciousness is in fact linked to perception: immediate consciousness is perception itself. Yet perception, for Bergson, follows a gradual progression along the scale of beings. Between the reflex functions of the spinal cord and the perceptive faculty of the brain—which enables the emergence of consciousness—the difference is one of degree rather than of kind. The complexity of the nervous system makes perception possible and, therefore, also choice, by diversifying potential actions and delaying the executed act. As a physiological phenomenon, consciousness in the present corresponds to the outline of possible actions within the nervous system. As a temporal phenomenon, it is a delay between stimulus and action. In other words, the different qualities perceived by different organisms, and the extent of their perception, are therefore related to the time available for action, which in turn depends on the complexity of their nervous system. The brain represents a culmination: it allows action to be deferred by opening multiple motor pathways. This delay creates an interval in which consciousness can insert itself—and, with it, the faculty of choice.
Thus, consciousness is duration. It corresponds to the time available to an organism to act. Contrary to what is found in the French spiritualist tradition, individual consciousness is not the particularisation of a spirit (or spiritual principle) passing through all living things. It is rather the particularisation of the temporality specific to life, which is a creative duration. Nevertheless, duration is not only a feature of the living: it is the ontological fabric of all things. This means that the differences between beings, and even the distinction between mind and matter, result from differences in rhythm: “if you abolish my consciousness, the material universe subsists exactly as it was; only, since you have removed that particular rhythm of duration which was the condition of my action upon things, these things draw back into themselves […] in an incomparably more divided duration” (Matter and Memory).
This leads Bergson to an original conception of perception, which is neither materialist nor spiritualist. Perception does not produce representations but delineates images within matter according to possible actions. Bergson thus rejects both materialism, which views consciousness as a mere epiphenomenon, and idealism, which reduces matter to a representation. Matter is composed of images, and among these images is one’s own body, whose capacity for action—depending on the time it has at its disposal—allows consciousness to emerge. In other words, perception is not a re-presentation but a selection: it results from the suppression of what is irrelevant to action. At the same time, Bergson maintains a form of dualism between consciousness and materiality—but a dualism not of substances, rather of rhythms. Consciousness is characterised by a creative recording of time, tending towards indeterminacy and freedom, while matter is characterised by a tendency towards repetition and inertia—towards spatiality.
Consciousness is therefore marked by memory. Nevertheless, memory itself can be more or less attached to the present, more or less subject to spatialisation. Habit memory—which underlies sensorimotor mechanisms—is directly engaged in the present of perception and in the demands of action. Pure memory, on the other hand, which preserves the past in the form of “memory-images,” is most often unconscious and is brought to the present only through an effort of recollection (a process that Bergson represents by a cone in Matter and Memory).
The dualism between consciousness and matter—one not strictly ontological, since both share duration, but rather a dualism of tendencies or of differentiated rhythms—has given rise to various interpretations, many of which draw Bergson towards spiritualism. It is true that some of Bergson’s texts are more ambiguous than others. In Mind–Energy, in particular, Bergson understands the difference between consciousness and matter as an ontological distinction, implying that the soul most likely survives the body.
A similar ambiguity lies in the concept of the élan vital.
e. Creative Evolution and the élan vital
In his 1907 bestseller Creative Evolution, Bergson entered the debates on evolutionism by introducing the concept of élan vital (vital impetus or vital impulse). The book should be read not merely as a stage within the development of Bergson’s own thought, but as a part of the broader scientific and intellectual debates of its time. It was indeed published at a time when discussions of evolution were particularly intense. Although Charles Darwin’s On the Origin of Species had been first published in 1859, and evolutionism was widely accepted by 1907, this period coincided with what the biologist Julian Huxley later called “the eclipse of Darwinism,” during which the role of natural selection was vigorously contested. Several theories competed with the Darwinian one, including mutationism (which Bergson described as mechanistic, like Darwin’s), orthogenesis, and neo-Lamarckism (finalistic or teleological theories).
Creative Evolution intervened in these debates, by both criticising existing evolutionary theories and suggesting an image intended to guide future research. Its central claim is that these theories fail to account for the efficacy of duration in biological evolution—a creativity that Bergson sought to capture through an image: the élan vital, which he compared to consciousness. This comparison led many critics to dismiss Bergson as a vitalist spiritualist whose thought lacked scientific rigour. Yet Bergson repeatedly emphasised the comparative or analogical nature of the link between life and consciousness. The élan vital was his way of naming the efficacy of duration in living beings—particularly in the processes of development and evolution. Since it is through consciousness that one first experiences duration’s creative power, Bergson used consciousness as an approximation for the efficacy of duration at work in life in general.
The book’s aim was primarily critical: to expose the limits of existing evolutionary theories. According to Bergson, these limits arise from the inadequacy of intelligence, which is incapable of conceiving duration. Scientific reasoning, grounded in intelligence, assumes that the future can be calculated from the present according to the principle of efficient causation—in other words, that everything is already given. When this mechanistic approach falls short, intelligence adopts another equally inadequate approach—simply the reverse side of the same coin: finalism. Finalism (also called teleology) assumes that things and beings are merely the realisation of a pre-established plan—again, everything is already given. For Bergson, this is the shared weakness of all evolutionary theories. His critique is not directed against the idea of evolution itself, but against the inability of both mechanistic and finalist theories to grasp the creativity of biological time—the unpredictability and historicity of life. The fallacy of these theories lies in their denial that, although the causes of a biological form may be explained retrospectively, they cannot be predicted, since each living form is unique, the product of a singular history: “How could we know beforehand a situation that is unique of its kind, that has never yet occurred and will never occur again?”
The concept of élan vital was intended to compensate for the shortcomings of evolutionary theories. It expresses the creativity of biological duration—life’s historicity—that is poorly understood by the biology of Bergson’s time. For Bergson, the élan vital, which characterises life, must be understood as an effort to act upon inert matter, that is, as an effort to insert indeterminacy into matter. This effort, he writes, both dissipates on contact with matter—because matter is infinitely divisible—and organises itself through it, since matter channels and constrains life’s creativity. There is therefore a unity of life (there is only one élan), but one that lies behind rather than ahead: a unity of impulse, not of purpose. This unity manifests itself in the complementarity of living beings, in the persistence of certain functions and structures across lineages. Yet the realisation of the élan vital occurs through differentiation, visible above all in the divergence of species. Following Darwin, Bergson did not conceive evolution as linear or hierarchical progress, but as a set of divergent directions of life: the torpor of plants, the instinct of mobile animals, and the intelligence of humanity. These three directions correspond to three degrees—and forms—of consciousness: a dormant consciousness in plants, which lack nervous systems; an awakened (albeit semi-dormant) consciousness in most mobile animals; and a free consciousness only in human beings. Consciousness, characterised by a certain rhythm of duration, is linked to the faculty of action. It entails a particular way of moving within matter, of knowing it, and thereby of acting upon it—of inserting indeterminacy into it.
The divergent directions are nevertheless complementary. Plants and animals divide energetic tasks: one stores energy, the other expends it. Animals and humans divide cognitive faculties: while an animal’s instinct knows matter from within but can apply itself only to a limited range of things directly useful to the organism, intelligence can be applied to an indefinite number of objects but grasps only their forms and relations. “There are things that intelligence alone is able to seek, but which, by itself, it will never find. These things instinct alone could find; but it will never seek them.” Intuition arises from an effort to synthesise these two faculties—an effort initiated by intelligence, which, recognising its own limitations, transcends itself by detaching from symbolic thought to rediscover the undulations of reality itself.
The élan vital thus conveys both the complementarity and the divergence of species, and of all living forms. This paradoxical nature of life comes from the fact that living beings—whether cells, organisms, or species—are nonetheless material, or rather that their matter is also alive. Life and matter are in fact two divergent tendencies of duration (or two rhythms), one tending towards indeterminacy, the other towards repetition, the compromise between the two producing living beings and their organisation. Evolution is therefore best understood as the progress of this struggle between the élan vital and the very condition of its realisation: matter.
The optimism of life’s creativity should not obscure the tragic dimension of Bergson’s thought: the élan vital is not infinite. It is, as Bergson writes, “a reality that is making itself within a reality that is unmaking itself,” an image inspired by the thermodynamics of his time. If human beings appear as a summit, it is only in a particular sense: they are one summit among others—since life diverges in multiple directions—and a temporary one, the form in which consciousness is, for the moment, most fully liberated.
Bergson’s philosophy of life therefore cannot be assimilated to traditional vitalism. The élan vital cannot be equated with a teleological vital principle such as in Driesch’s theory: on the contrary, it is open-ended and unpredictable. Nor is it an ontological principle separate from matter: the difference between life and matter is a difference in rhythm. Moreover, the rhythm of life is not wholly distinct from that of matter, for matter is both life’s opposite and its necessary complement—the cause of its detours as well as the source of its inventiveness.
By the second half of the twentieth century, Bergson’s biological speculations had come to be regarded as outdated. His critique of Darwinism, together with his metaphorical style, led Julian Huxley, one of the founders of the modern synthesis of Mendelian genetics and Darwinian evolution, to describe him as “a good poet but a bad scientist.” Yet in Creative Evolution, Bergson’s intention was never to advance empirical claims, but to engage a dialogue with science by proposing new theoretical directions and epistemological perspectives—“nothing that could not in time be confirmed by the tests of biology” (The Two Sources of Morality and Religion).
The élan vital should therefore be understood neither as a literal vital force nor as a merely metaphorical expression. It is Bergson’s way of designating the efficacy of duration in life—its creative, historical, and open-ended character—while also indicating the limits of the mechanistic and finalist frameworks available in his time. In that sense, the concept has ontological significance, though not as a principle separate from matter, and it also plays a heuristic role by orienting further philosophical and scientific inquiry. It is this aspect of Bergson’s philosophy that has contributed to the renewed interest it has attracted among those interested in biology in the early twenty-first century.
f. Individuality, Society, and Morality
The situation is different when Bergson turns to questions of religion and morality. Here, he writes, it is a matter of “going beyond the conclusions we reached in Creative Evolution” (The Two Sources of Morality and Religion). The epistemological status of this work is therefore different: the aim is no longer to provide an empirically grounded concept capable of guiding science, but rather to draw on empirical evidence to move further, in order to suggest plausible hypotheses. Bergson thus extends certain insights from his philosophy of life to the moral and social domains.
The élan vital is both one and manifold, springing forth in a multitude of directions. This tension between unity and multiplicity is not limited to the evolution of species; it characterises all living beings. Each living being is simultaneously one and many: an organism is an individual composed of a colony of cells, each of which also possesses a form of individuality. There are therefore varying degrees of individuality, both according to the level of organisation and according to the integration between these levels. At the level of the organism, in particular, the more complex and centralised the nervous system, the more individualised the being—that is, the more independent it becomes from external circumstances. Just as the élan vital, which runs through all living beings and all species, is one before being multiple, the individuality of the organism precedes the multiplicity of its parts (for Bergson, the organism’s constitution results from the dissociation of an initial individuality into cells). Admittedly, individuality is never complete in living beings—not only because the organism results from the dissociation of cells, but also because it is never fully closed: it remains in relation with its environment and other living beings, and is always potentially multiple through reproduction. Yet only organisms are true individuals. Unlike physical objects, which can be divided infinitely, biological individuality is not a mere conceptual convenience. Biological individuality is an ongoing generation resulting from the action of duration upon living beings—an action Bergson calls ageing (but which also encompasses plasticity, development, and all phenomena of organic memory), and which is specific to each organism.
This understanding of biology in terms of dual tendencies forms the basis of Bergson’s philosophy of morality. Just as the biological individual is driven by both a tendency towards association and a tendency towards dissociation, human societies are both one and many, closed in on themselves, yet also potentially open to the rest of humanity. From this duality of tendencies running through societies arises a corresponding duality of morals.
There is a closed morality characterised by the pursuit of internal cohesion and distinction from other groups. Since individuals cannot survive in isolation, societies develop strict rules to secure solidarity among their members. To ensure obedience, they rely on a human faculty that Bergson calls the fabulation function, which gives rise to a certain form of religion—static or closed religion. This fabulation function produces myths and gods that guarantee obedience to the rules of the closed society. Cohesion in such societies is thus maintained by exclusion and sustained by fear, leaving them perpetually threatened by conflict or war.
However, there is another kind of morality and another kind of religion, which do not aim at internal cohesion but are instead characterised by openness and creativity. Open morality is universal and therefore alien to war. Its horizon is a society that would encompass all of humanity. This morality is not grounded in fixed, pre-established rules but in emotions that Bergson describes as creative. These emotions are creative because, rather than being caused by representations, they give rise to new ones. They spring from a mystical intuition—an élan d’amour, an impulse of love—that constitutes the emotional counterpart of the élan vital and arises from the experience of shared duration with other living beings. Through this experience, the individual transcends itself, opening not only to other members of its society but to all humans, to animals, to plants, and all of nature.
This form of transcendence beyond the human condition is not a departure from the biological, for morality requires recognising one’s dependence on the totality of life (one’s individuality is not closed) and on its history (one is merely a transitory product of evolution). The élan d’amour thus constitutes dynamic religion: an affective surge that grounds genuine religion, one that is not based on rigid obligations or doctrines constraining action, but on the mobility and progress that inspire creative acts. It should therefore be emphasised that, for Bergson, the morality that arises from mystical intuition is not an esoteric experience confined to interiority: on the contrary, it is oriented towards action and creation.
g. Biological History and Human History
Bergson approaches human history through the lens of his understanding of biology. The élan vital is characterised by a paradoxical nature resulting from the coexistence of two tendencies within living beings: the tendency towards unpredictability and creativity, and the tendency towards mechanism and inertia that arises from material actualisation. According to Bergson, history expresses this same duality through the development of two kinds of progress—spiritual progress and material or technical progress. He thus posits a law of dichotomy in history, according to which tendencies, as they are realised, divide into divergent and even contradictory directions. Material progress is therefore distinct from, and often opposed to, spiritual progress. This law of dissociation also gives rise to a law of double frenzy, with each form of progress being marked by the compulsion to pursue itself to its extreme. Historical movement, like the élan vital, thus appears as a tendency encompassing a multiplicity of tendencies—multiple only in their actualisation, that is, in their development through history. Unlike biological evolution, however, in which tendencies unfold across separate lineages, in human history they evolve within the same society: mechanical and spiritual progress flourish successively—they alternate rather than coexist.
While there are regularities in history (hence the metaphor of a “law”), legality here is only an approximation. If genuine laws existed, the possible would already be implicitly given in advance, and time would have no effect. On the contrary, in both biology and history, duration is the continuous creation of possibility, not merely of reality: it constantly produces unique, unrepeatable, and therefore unpredictable situations. History does not repeat itself; the Battle of Austerlitz was fought once and will never be fought again. Since identical historical conditions can never recur, identical events can never reappear. And since a law necessarily implies that the same causes always produce the same effects, history, like life, does not deal in laws but in particular facts and the equally particular circumstances in which they occur.
Hence, history—like biology—calls for a new conception of scientific knowledge.
3. Reputation and Reception
a. Bergson’s Influence during the Twentieth Century
Bergson’s reception is paradoxical. His influence was immense, both in France and beyond, but short-lived. He had disciples yet founded no school. Initially hailed as a philosopher who broke with tradition, he was soon judged outdated, even reactionary, and aligned with conservative thought.
Beyond public acclaim and the popularity of his lectures among a diverse audience of essayists, politicians, poets, and social elites, Bergson was quickly recognised in philosophical circles following the publication of his thesis. The first readers of Time and Free Will felt they were witnessing a genuine philosophical event. Nevertheless, identified as anti-Kantian, Bergson’s philosophy provoked scepticism among his peers. While many acknowledged the conceptual achievement of Matter and Memory, they also opposed his criticism of intelligence, often interpreted as anti-rationalist. This interpretation of Bergsonism was soon challenged by Édouard Le Roy, mathematician and philosopher, in an 1899 article in the Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale. Le Roy saw in Bergsonism a means of questioning the omnipotence of symbols in science and rethinking the relation between science and morality. According to Le Roy, Bergson inaugurated a new form of positivism—what he called spiritual positivism. Another of his early disciples was Charles Péguy, who at first offered a quite different interpretation of Bergson’s philosophy, viewing it as a hymn to human freedom in a world without God, before later drawing it into dialogue with Christian thought.
Bergson’s philosophy also resonated in artistic circles. With the publication of “Introduction to Metaphysics” in 1903, he became a key reference for Symbolist poets seeking to rediscover an emotional and contemplative relation to the world.
Politically, Bergson’s thought appealed to a variety of thinkers, particularly among left-leaning intellectuals. Georges Sorel, theorist of revolutionary syndicalism, frequently referred to Bergson, even proposing a Marxist reading of Bergsonian philosophy. Historians, too, found inspiration in his conception of time and change. However, the post-war period marked a turning point. Bergson’s philosophy came to be seen as outdated and conservative—a perception reinforced by his patriotic and chauvinistic speeches at the beginning of the war. Left-wing intellectuals such as Julien Benda, Paul Nizan, and Georges Politzer then attacked Bergsonism as a bastion of tradition, promoting a vision of history rooted in liberal and bourgeois values.
The scientific reception of Bergson’s work was mixed and generally reserved. Physicists largely dismissed it as incompatible with Einstein’s theory of relativity, yet his ideas found more sympathetic audiences elsewhere. Time and Free Will and Matter and Memory were widely discussed by psychologists, while Creative Evolution provoked significant debate among biologists and evolutionary theorists—most of whom, however, rejected the notion of an élan vital as too vague or metaphysical. As the century advanced, Bergsonism faced increasing criticism from biologists and gradually faded from view. His biological philosophy, acknowledging neither the achievements of Darwinism nor those of Mendelian genetics, soon appeared obsolete with the rise of the modern synthesis in the mid-twentieth century, which united Darwin’s theory of natural selection with Mendel’s laws of heredity. Nevertheless, several founders of this synthesis—including Sewall Wright, Julian Huxley, Ronald Fisher, and Theodosius Dobzhansky—continued to engage with Bergson’s ideas, if only to refute them. Some even regarded Bergsonism as a philosophical complement to Darwinism, a spiritual counterpart deemed necessary for this broader change in worldview. But the hardening of the modern synthesis, with its increasing explanatory and ontological reductionism (adaptation as the sole valid explanation, and the gene as the only relevant level of selection), ultimately sealed Bergson’s marginalisation within science.
b. International Influence
The discussions of Bergson’s ideas by theorists of the modern synthesis—spanning multiple disciplines and countries—illustrate the breadth of his international impact. Indeed, his reach extended far beyond France and even beyond the Western world.
Bergson’s philosophy, propelled by the fame of its author, influenced numerous philosophical, artistic, and political movements across the globe. He was read attentively by Anglo-Saxon pragmatists, notably William James, with whom he corresponded extensively. In Italy, Bergson was widely discussed from the early twentieth century and exerted a profound influence on Futurism. In Finland, his work gave rise to debates that brought Bergsonian philosophy into conversation with Durkheimian sociology. The translation of Creative Evolution into English, Spanish, Swedish, Polish, and German contributed greatly to his European success.
Beyond Europe, Bergson’s ideas resonated strongly in Japan. Kitarō Nishida, founder of the Kyoto School, drew inspiration from Bergson’s conception of flux and immediate experience beyond symbols. The nominalist philosopher Shûzô Kuki also made frequent reference to Bergson’s work. In China, Bergson’s thought was received in an eclectic fashion. It played a major role in early twentieth-century philosophical debates, inspired avant-garde artistic movements, and informed both left- and right-wing ideological currents.
Nevertheless, Bergson’s fame declined rapidly after the First World War, and by the second half of the century, his work had largely fallen into obscurity. By the 1980s, Bergson was cited chiefly as a historical figure of early modern thought.
c. Bergson’s Revival
The turn of the twenty-first century marked a revival of interest in Bergson’s philosophy, initiated notably by Gilles Deleuze’s Bergsonism, which emphasised the (more Deleuzian than Bergsonian) concepts of multiplicity and virtuality in order to criticise the omnipotence of Hegelianism. This renewal continued with the work of Frédéric Worms, who founded the Société des Amis de Bergson in 2006, while several Japanese universities launched a research programme entitled Bergson in Japan. Bergson’s revival unfolded across several countries, and the convergence of these international initiatives gave rise to the Global Bergsonism Research Project, which seeks to articulate the worldwide reception of Bergson’s work and has led to the creation of Bergsoniana (2021), the first peer-reviewed journal entirely devoted to Bergson’s philosophy and its contemporary extensions.
This revival has also brought to light several previously unpublished writings, despite Bergson’s explicit wish that his manuscripts be destroyed after his death and that no further works appear posthumously. His lectures at the Collège de France were published in the early twenty-first century, followed by a new collection of his correspondence in 2024. These sources inspired a fresh wave of scholarship—both on Bergson’s historical thought and on its contemporary significance.
In particular, though not exclusively, Bergson’s philosophy of science—his reflections on the relation between lived and measured time, his critique of evolutionary theories, and his rejection of reductionism—seemed to have regained new relevance. His ideas were also revisited in research on memory and, more recently, in decolonial studies, where they were used to rethink questions of gender and race. This contemporary Bergsonism does not merely repeat Bergson’s propositions; it renews and reinterprets them, thereby fulfilling one of Bergson’s own hopes: that his fluid concepts, continuing to inspire thought owing to their very instability, might evolve and refine themselves through contact with empirical discovery—philosophy thus advancing hand in hand with science and touching a reality that is always in the process of creating itself.
4. References and Further Reading
a. Primary Sources (Selected Works)
- Bergson, Henri. [1889] 1910. Time and Free Will. Trans. F. L. Pogson. London: George Allen & Unwin.
- Bergson, Henri. [1896] 1911. Matter and Memory. Trans. N. M. Paul and W. S. Palmer. London: George Allen & Unwin.
- Bergson, Henri. [1900] 1914. Laughter: An Essay on the Meaning of the Comic. Trans. C. Brereton and F. Rothwell. New York: MacMillan.
- Bergson, Henri. [1907] 1911. Creative Evolution. Trans. A. Mitchell. London: Macmillan.
- Bergson, Henri. [1911] 1920. Mind-Energy. Trans. H. Wildon Carr. New York: Henry Holt and Co.
- Bergson, Henri. [1922] 1965. Duration and Simultaneity. Trans L. Jacobson. Indianapolis: Bobb-Merrill.
- Bergson, Henri. [1932] 1935. The Two Sources of Morality and Religion. Trans. R. Ashley Audra and C. Brereton. New York: Henry Holt.
- Bergson, Henri. [1934] 1946. The Creative Mind. Trans. M. L. Andison. New York: Philosophical Library.
b. Secondary Sources
i. Introduction to Bergson’s Life and Philosophy
- Azouvi, François. 2007. La Gloire de Bergson. Essai sur le Magistère Philosophique. Paris: Gallimard.
- Deleuze, Gilles. [1963] 1988. Bergsonism. Trans. H. Tomlinson. New York: Zone Books.
- Guerlac, Suzanne. 2006. Thinking in Time: an Introduction to Henri Bergson. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Herring, Emily. 2024. Herald of a Restless World. How Henri Bergson Brought Philosophy to the People. London/New York : Basic Books.
- Jankelevitch, Vladimir. 2015. Henri Bergson. Trans. N. F. Schott. Durham (North Carolina): Duke University Press.
- Lawlor, Leonard. 2003. The Challenge of Bergsonism: Phenomenology, Ontology, Ethics. London: Continuum Press.
- Moore, F.C.T. 1996. Bergson: Thinking Backwards. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Mullarkey, John. 2000. Bergson and Philosophy: An Introduction. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
- Sinclair, Mark. 2019. Bergson. Oxon and New York : Routledge.
- Sinclair, Mark and Yaron Wolf (eds.). 2021. The Bergsonian Mind. Oxon/New York: Routledge.
- Soulez Philippe and Frédéric Worms. 2002. Bergson. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
- Worms, Frédéric. 2004. Bergson ou les Deux Sens de la Vie. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
ii. Going Further
- Antliff, Mark. 1993. Inventing Bergson: Cultural Politics and the Parisian Avant-Garde. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- François, Arnaud (ed.). 2010. L’Évolution Créatrice de Bergson. Paris: Vrin.
- Gunter, Pete A. Y. 2023. Getting Bergson Straight: The Contributions of Intuition to the Sciences. Wilmington, DE: Vernon Press.
- Hirai, Yasushi (ed.). 2023. Bergson’s Scientific Metaphysics. London: Bloomsbury.
- Lefebvre, Alexandre. 2013. Human Rights as a Way of Life: On Bergson’s Political Philosophy. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
- Lefebvre, Alexandre and Melanie White (eds.). 2012. Bergson, Politics, and Religion. Durham, NC: Duke University Press.
- Moravec, Matyáš. 2024. Henri Bergson and the Philosophy of Religion: God, Freedom, and Duration. London and New York: Routledge.
- Mullarkey, John (ed.). 2006. The New Bergson. Manchester: Manchester University Press.
- Pilkington, A. E. 1976. Bergson and His Influence: A Reassessment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Posteraro, Tano S. 2022. Bergson’s Philosophy of Biology: Virtuality, Tendency and Time. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
- Tahar, Mathilde. 2022. “Bergson’s Vitalisms.” Parrhesia (36): 4–24.
- Tahar, Mathilde. 2024. Du Finalisme en Biologie. Bergson et la Théorie de l’Évolution. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
- Zanfi, Caterina. 2013. Bergson et la Philosophie Allemande, 1907–1932. Paris: Armand Colin.
Author Information
Mathilde Tahar
Email: mathildetahar@gmail.com
University College London
United Kingdom