Medieval Theories of Practical Reason

Practical reason is the employment of reason in service of living a good life, and the great medieval thinkers all gave accounts of it. Practical reason is reasoning about, or better toward, an action, and an action always has a goal or end, this end being understood to be in some sense good. The medievals generally concurred that it was always in some way directed toward the agent’s ultimate goal or final end (although there were important differences in how the agent’s relation to the final end was conceived).

In every medieval account, we find important roles for the intellect and the will—for the intellect in identifying goods to be honored and pursued, and for the will in tending toward such goods. Medieval accounts always paid attention to the relationship between practical reason and the moral trinity of happiness, law, and virtue. Perhaps the most important difference between these accounts is that some philosophers assign primacy to the intellect but others assign it to the will. This difference has led historians to identify schools of thought called intellectualism and voluntarism.

This article traces some of the main lines of medieval thought about practical reason, from its roots in Aristotle and Augustine through some of its most interesting expressions in Aquinas and Scotus, the ablest exponents, respectively, of intellectualism and voluntarism. The article points out the important differences among theorists, but also highlights the themes common to all the medieval, and it indicates some points of contact with contemporary work on practical reason, including debates about particularism and internalism.

Precursors: Aristotle and Augustine
Intellectualist Theory: Aquinas
Voluntarist Theory: Scotus
Medieval and Modern
Conclusion: Common Themes among the Medievals
References and Further Reason
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1.Precursors: Aristotle and Augustine

The two most important influences upon medieval thought about practical reason were Aristotle and St. Augustine, and this first section identifies a few of the key ideas they bequeathed to their successors.

a. Aristotle

Aristotle’s theory is teleological and eudaimonist: All action is undertaken for an end, and our proximate ends, when we act rationally, form a coherent hierarchical structure leading up to our final end of eudaimonia (happiness, flourishing). Although we presuppose rather than reason about our final end formally considered—it is that which we pursue for its own sake, and for the sake of which we pursue all else; it is that which makes life worthwhile—practical reason does help us work out the correct way to think about just what that final end is, and about how to move toward it. Reason does this by means of the practical syllogism: The major premise identifies the end, some good recognized as worthy of pursuit; the minor premise interprets the agent’s situation in relation to the end; the conclusion is characteristically a choice leading directly to action that pursues means to the end (for example, Some pleasant relaxation would be good right now; reading this novel would be pleasant and relaxing; I shall read it (and straightaway I commence reading)). The work practical reason does in formulating the minor premise and identifying the means is called deliberation. While we cannot deliberate about the end identified in the major premise as an end, we can deliberate about it under its aspect as a means to some further end. Thus practical reason can (although seldom will it explicitly do so in practice) take the form of a chain of syllogisms, with the major premise of the first identifying the final end to be pursued, and the conclusion both identifying the means to that end and supplying the major premise of the next (now serving as a proximate end), until we finally reach down to something to be done here and now (the means to the most proximate end). Here is a compressed example: I should flourish as a human being, and my flourishing requires the practice of civic virtue, so I should practice civic virtue; I should practice civic virtue, in my circumstances civic virtue requires me to enlist in the army to defend my city, so I should enlist; I should enlist, and here is a recruiter to whom I must speak in order to enlist; I choose to speak to the recruiter.

Notice that in this syllogism the premises do not mention desire—the majors do not state “I want X,” but rather that X is a good to be pursued. Yet the conclusion does mention desire, or rather is a desire (for that is what choice is, deliberated desire). This is not an oversight on Aristotle’s part. Although he holds that reason and desire work together to produce action, he insists that desire naturally tends to what cognition identifies as good—as he puts it at Metaphysics 1072a29, “desire is consequent upon opinion rather than opinion on desire, for the thinking is the starting point.” Reason serves as the formal cause of action by identifying the actions (determining what “form” our actions should take) leading to the apprehended good, which is the final cause or end of action; desire serves as the efficient cause, putting the man in motion toward the end. So when a prospective end is recognized as good, a desire for it follows. The practical syllogism serves to transmit the desire for the end identified by reason as good down to means identified by reason as the appropriate way to the end.

Yet, because cognition includes sense perception, things other than those identified by reason can be presented to desire as good (as any dieter knows when offered dessert). This allows Aristotle to propose a solution to the problem of akrasia or “weakness of will,” the choosing of something we know to be bad—to put it crudely, we know it is bad, but it looks good. For reasoning to be effectively practical, and for practice to be rational, the desires must be in line with reason; for the desires to be consistently in line with reason, the moral virtues, which “train” the emotions to bring them into line with reason, are necessary. When the moral virtues, together with prudence, are present, Aristotle takes it that reasoning well and acting accordingly will follow naturally (we can speak of virtue as “second nature”).

b. Augustine

The idea of virtuous action becoming natural is one of the points on which Augustine will disagree with Aristotle. He learns from his own experience (for example, in his robbing of the pear tree recounted in Confessions II) and from his reflections on the sin of the angels (see On Free Choice of the Will III) that the will can choose what the intellect rejects. Although the intellect is required for willing in the sense that it presents objects as good to the will, willing has no cause other than the will itself. Augustine, unlike some later Augustinians, is a eudaimonist, seeing our final end as eternal life in peace, that is, in right relation to and enjoyment of God (see The City of God XIX). Yet it should be noted that, drawing on his own experience and the writings of St. Paul, he identifies “two loves” of the will, love of God and love of self, and holds that the struggle between these two for ascendancy is the key to each human life, and indeed to history. No trace of such a struggle is to be found in Aristotle; nor is there any such role for faith as we find in Augustine. Both in Confessions XI and in The City of God XIX Augustine chronicles the woes of temporal human existence, and the impossibility of finding peace, our final end, during our life on earth. It is thus in some sense reasonable for us to turn humbly to faith in God as our only hope for salvation. This turning, or conversion, requires an act of willed submission to God. Only after this can the intellect know, by faith, the true character of our final end, and thus only after such willing can practical reason become truly informed as to how to act. The need for conversion brings one more un-Aristotelian idea into the picture, that of obedience to divine law.

c. Intellectualism and Voluntarism

Aristotle’s account of practical reason could be characterized as intellectualist, not because he ignores the very important role of desire, but because reason plays the leading role, and desire is naturally inclined to follow reason (“desire is consequent upon opinion … for the thinking is the starting point”). Further, although Aristotle employs the concept of rational wish, there is serious debate as to whether this can rightly be identified with what the medievals, following Augustine, call the will. By contrast, Augustine may be termed a voluntarist, not because reason is unimportant, but because with him it is the will that plays the primary role. As we have seen, even in the absence of passion, the will may choose contrary to the judgment of the intellect, and it is only by willed humility that we can come to know our true final end by faith.

Throughout much of the Christian Middle Ages, Augustine’s influence predominates. And although much important work was done on topics highly relevant to practical reasoning—for example, passages in Peter Lombard’s Sentences, and the work of St. Anselm on the will and of Abelard on ethics—practical reasoning itself was not generally treated in a rigorous and systematic way. But in the twelfth century, translations of Aristotle’s works, together with Muslim and Jewish commentaries, began to flow into Western Europe, and to gain in influence, eventually rivaling or surpassing the importance of Augustine’s thought. These thinkers do treat practical reasoning in rigorous fashion, and under their influence, so too do the great thinkers of the High Middle Ages. In doing so, all draw on both Aristotle and Augustine, and although it is common practice to identify some as “Aristotelians” and “intellectualists,” and others as “Augustinians” and “voluntarists,” this does run the risk of oversimplifying. The reader should keep in mind that there is no one account of the relation between intellect and will that all intellectualists held, nor one opposed account that all voluntarists held. Instead, scholars sort thinkers according to whether they hold certain characteristic theses concerning such questions as these: Is the intellect or the will the higher power? Is the will a passive power (a “moved mover”) or an active one (a “self-mover”)? What sort of cause does the intellect exert on the will’s choice—does it specify the act of will, or can the will act independently and control its own choices (and can it act contrary to judgment)? A metaphor commonly used by those now classified as voluntarists was that of the Lord and the Lampbearer: The will is the lord, deciding where to go; the intellect contributes to the decision, but in the same manner as the servant who lights the way (or rather the possible ways) with a lamp (see for example Henry of Ghent, Quodlibet Iq14). Intellectualists, by contrast, would see the intellect as the lord, and the will as the lieutenant or executive officer.

In the intellectualist camp we can probably include St. Albert (see the first McCluskey entry for a discussion) and John of Paris; in the voluntarist camp, St. Bonaventure and Henry of Ghent. Others, such as Giles of Rome, occupy a position in the disputed middle ground (see Kent for an intellectualist reading of Giles; Eardley for a moderately voluntarist reading). The following sections will focus on the two figures who are arguably the most important and influential thinkers of the High Middle Ages, taking Aquinas as a representative of intellectualism, and Scotus as a representative of voluntarism. But it should be kept in mind that Aquinas treats Augustine as an authority and has a much more robust conception of the will than does Aristotle, and likewise that Scotus draws heavily upon Aristotle and insists upon a very important role for the intellect.

2. Intellectualist Theory: Aquinas

Like both Aristotle and Augustine, St. Thomas Aquinas (1225-1274) is a eudaimonist; like Augustine he takes seriously both obedience to divine law and the role of the will in the genesis of action; yet like Aristotle he is an intellectualist. (This is generally accepted, but it should be noted that some scholars have argued for more somewhat more voluntarist readings of Aquinas than that offered below. See Eardley and Westberg for sources, discussion, and criticism of these interpretations.) For Aquinas, practical reasoning plays out in a dynamic exchange between intellect and will, an exchange in which intellect always has the first word (reason being the first principle of human action), but in which the will plays a key role and the agent remains free.

a. The Interaction of Intellect and Will in Generating Action

For Aquinas, the will tends naturally toward the good, but to act it must have the good presented to it by reason in its practical capacity. Further, after apprehending and willing the good, the agent must decide whether and how to pursue it, which involves a process of collaboration between intellect and will. Let us begin with an example, making use of Ralph McInerny’s immortal character, Fifi LaRue. In the midst of a bad day, Fifi sees a travel poster advertising a Roman holiday, apprehends “how nice that would be,” and forms a wish to go. She considers the idea as befitting, and enjoys it. Nothing seems to stand in the way; the trip would be delightful and cause no problems; she forms the intention to go. But she must take counsel as to how she could accomplish it. Due to time constraints, she must fly, but could take a bus or taxi to the airport; she consents to both. Yet the bus would be so crowded … let it be the taxi then, she judges, and so chooses. Here is a taxi; she must hail it by raising her arm. So she commands, and so uses her arm. The taxi pulls up, and off she goes.

This example involves the steps and terms Aquinas spells out in questions 8-17 of the prima secundae (the first part of the second part of the Summa theologiae), and we should now look at some of the details of this complex discussion: The intellect apprehends something as good and thereby presents it to the will, which then wills or wishes that good as an end—call this simple willing. (Strictly speaking, it would be more proper to say the agent apprehends the good by means of her intellect and simply wills it by means of her will; this is always what Aquinas means, although for convenience he often speaks of the intellect apprehending and so forth.) This does not yet mean that the agent pursues the good; she may decide not to for a variety of reasons—perhaps it is pleasant but sinful, and she immediately rejects it—or may be as yet undecided. She may then continue to consider the good, apprehend it as befitting in some ways, and, in a second act of will regarding the possible end, enjoy it (while we perfectly enjoy only an end possessed, we may imperfectly enjoy or entertain the idea of possessing it). Again, actual pursuit need not follow—perhaps the good is befitting but not currently feasible (Fifi, perhaps, lacks the money). Finally, the agent may actually undertake to pursue this good as an end, to tend toward it, and this act of will Aquinas calls intention (and here again, Aquinas is explicit that an act of reason precedes this act of will; cf. q12a1ad3).

Now intending the good as an end, the agent must determine how best to pursue it—she must decide upon means to the end. When the means are not immediately obvious, the agent deliberates or takes counsel, in which reason seeks out acceptable ways to the end; such ways being found the will then consents to them. Reason must then issue a judgment (q14a1) as to which is preferable, followed by the act of will called choice (q13, q15a3ad3). So, Fifi took counsel as to how to reach the airport, identifies and accepts two ways (bus or taxi), then judges the taxi superior and so chooses that means. But in considering how to get from America to Rome, she is able to skip the counsel/consent stage because the means (flying) are immediately obvious (she has no time for sailing).

The choice having been made, it is time to execute. Here again we see the same pattern of an act of intellect, command, followed by an act of will, use, whereby the will employs faculties of the soul, parts of the body, or material objects to make the choice effective. So when the taxi draws near, Fifi sees that she must wave, and commands “this (waving) is to be done.” This command informs, or gives exact shape to, her already present will to take a taxi (her choice). Her will then uses her arm, puts it in motion.

Now the process described is a complex one, having as many as twelve steps from the initial apprehension of a good down to use. Do we really go through all of this? Aquinas does not mean that we consciously rehearse all the steps every time we perform an action (just as we do not consciously rehearse rules of grammar in articulating a thought). The twelve-step process is a logical reconstruction of the role of intellect and will in generating action. The steps are those we could consciously rehearse, and perhaps sometimes do (if facing a complicated matter, say, or if doggedly pressed for an explanation or justification of a past action). Usually, our actual practical reasoning will be much more concise. Daniel Westberg and others have argued that we should understand Aquinas to have in mind a streamlined version of the process centered around intention (apprehension and intention), decision (judgment and choice), and execution (command and use), with intellect and will working in unison at each stage. Other acts mentioned by Aquinas, such as counsel and consent, may serve auxiliary roles in complex situations.

Westberg stresses that we should not take Aquinas to mean that at each stage intellect renders its judgment and then the will decides whether or not to follow it—as we will see, this is the way of the voluntarists. Instead, the will naturally tends toward the good presented to it by the intellect at each stage. So for example in discussing whether choice is an act of intellect or of will, Aquinas says choice “is materially an act of the will, but formally an act of the reason” (q13a1)—roughly, the intellect in presenting some particular thing or action as good “forms” or makes specific the will’s general tendency toward the good (Aquinas follows Aristotle in maintaining that, like substances, accidents, including actions, can be analyzed in terms of form and matter). It is because the act of choice is completed by the will (judgment alone is not yet choice) that Aquinas is prepared to call it an act of will. Yet there is a real sense in which the stage Westberg calls “decision” comprises one act of the reasoning agent, an act whose form derives from reason and whose matter is supplied by will.

Voluntarists will charge that here the intellect is determining the will, which is thus not free. Now Aquinas calls that free which “retains the power of being inclined to various things” (Iaq83a1); a subject is free if it has this power. A rock is not free just because it can be inclined to heat or chill by the external power of fire or ice. Aquinas’s implied response to the voluntarist charge in the course of his discussion of choice is that the act of choice is free because the judgment that forms it is free, and the judgment is free because in considering any particular good, reason can focus on how it is good or on how it is lacking in goodness, leading to a judgment for or against it (q13a6). Worth noting, too, is that the will (and those other affective powers, the passions) play a role in attracting or diverting the attention of reason during the counsel it takes prior to judgment. But Aquinas’s more complete response would be that, strictly, it is not the will or reason that is free; the person is free in making the judgment and thus in making the choice the judgment informs. The intellect does not make the judgment, the person—the willing and feeling, as well as thinking, person—makes it by means of his intellect. The person is the subject that “retains the power” of, say, sitting closer to or further from the fire and thus being hot or cold; he exercises this power by means of his faculties of reason and will.

All of this shows how things can in many ways be more complicated, and less mechanical, than the initial description of Fifi’s pursuit of a Roman holiday suggested. One especially important factor, just touched on, is the reflexivity of both intellect and will. The will, for example, uses both intellect and itself throughout the process of deliberation (see q16a4c&ad3). In reaching her judgment, Fifi focused on the bus being crowded, but if her affections were more attuned to saving money, she might have focused instead on its economy. Further, she could at any point consider whether she should deliberate further and decide whether or not to do so. There is a potentially infinite regress here, but not an actual one. In taking counsel, having consented to taking the bus, she could yield to impatience and hop on the bus she sees rather than thinking further and realizing that a taxi would be better. Neither the bus nor the taxi, nor for that matter any other means or particular good in this life, is a perfect good. Thus none of them determine reason in its favor. Our judgment, and thus our choice, remain free. This highlights one reason Aquinas can be called an intellectualist, namely that he identifies reason as the source of freedom (see Iaq59a3: “wherever there is intellect, there is free-will”). But again, if this seems, paradoxically, to locate freedom in reason rather than will, it is well to remember that Aquinas’s talk of the intellect doing this, and the will that, is all shorthand for the person acting by means of each faculty. It is the person, not her faculties, who judges and chooses; and does both freely.

b. The Practical Syllogism

But how does such reasoning relate to the Aristotelian notion of the practical syllogism Aquinas adopts? The intellectual acts regarding, and the pursuant intention of, the end supply the major premise (say, “I should go to Rome.”). The minor premise is supplied by deliberation, resulting in judgment and choice (“Taking a cab to the airport is the best way to Rome.”). This may take a major premise-minor premise form as above, but often the deliberation of the agent would be better represented as a longer argument with several premises, or as an iterated series of two-premise arguments finally reaching down to the concrete action. In this case, the means to the end initially chosen would then become the object of intention as a proximate end (q12a2), and counsel would be taken as to the means to that end, and so forth, until something that can be done here and now is reached (much as we saw above in the discussion of Aristotle).

Two questions present themselves at this point: What sort of reasoning goes into the formation of intentions, and how is this reasoning, and the reasoning involved in counsel, done well or ill? Sketching an answer to these questions requires a discussion of happiness, law, and virtue.

c. Happiness, Law, and Virtue

Aquinas agrees with Aristotle that we have a final end, and with Augustine that it is not to be attained in this life (it is not a Roman holiday, unless perhaps in a very metaphorical sense). Using the term “happiness” is a potentially misleading, but common, translation of beatitude. Blessedness or flourishing would be better, for in fact our final end is our completion or perfection. Aquinas takes it that we all agree, or would agree upon reflection, on that. There is neither need nor room for practical reasoning about it. Yet we disagree over that in which it consists: one says wealth, another power, another (Fifi, perhaps) pleasure. And here we can reason: The mere fact that Aquinas wrote the first five questions of the prima secundae shows that he thought so. There he argues that because the will wills the good universally, and only God is universally good, our final end is attained in virtuous activity culminating in the right relation to God (although we may not know that the happiness we seek can be found only in and with God), which consists principally in loving contemplation and secondarily in obedient service. Only this perfects our nature as rational creatures. Although Aquinas agrees with Augustine that this end can be attained, or even adequately understood, only by God’s grace, Aquinas takes it that we do tend naturally (even if inadequately) toward it, and that its attainment fulfills, as well as transcends, our nature (“Grace does not destroy nature but perfects it” Iaq1a8ad2). What reason is able to make out about our final end, then, is reliable and authoritative, even if always incomplete.

There is a long-standing controversy in Aquinas scholarship concerning the relationship between what Aquinas calls imperfect and perfect beatitude: Do we have a natural final end of humanly virtuous activity and a distinct supernatural final end of contemplation of and friendship with God? Or do we have just one final end that is naturally unattainable? Here readers are referred to Bradley for a very thorough discussion of the issues involved.

Because by our nature we have a final end, any other end we have (going to Rome, perhaps) could be reconsidered in its light, and since everything we do is (perhaps unconsciously) done for the sake of the final end (Ia-IIaeq1a6), every other good we pursue, though seen as an end, is also a means to our final end, and under this aspect can be deliberated about, evaluated, and judged appropriate or not. In this sense, ends too are objects of counsel and judgment (q14a2). Fifi might adopt the end of going to Rome capriciously, but she might also stand back and take counsel about it under its aspect of a means to her conception of her final end. That is the sort of reasoning that can go into the formation of intentions. To see how Aquinas thinks such reasoning, as well as the reasoning about means, should be done, we must look at how his discussion of the final end relates to his discussion of the natural law.

As natural creatures, we have a natural inclination (in fact, an ordered set of natural inclinations) toward our perfection as human beings. As rational creatures, we can understand and endorse these inclinations, and articulate them into principles of practical reason, which are at the same time precepts of the natural law. How so? As Pamela Hall and Jean Porter have argued, the process of articulation involves a reflective, and developing, grasp of human nature and its tendencies, including an understanding of it and them as good. This understanding is ultimately founded on the recognition that human nature is created and directed by God, Goodness itself (this recognition can be achieved, however imperfectly, by means of natural knowledge of God). This allows the articulated principles to meet the criteria of law (q90a4): They are ordinances of reason (our own, and ultimately God’s) for the common good (due to our social nature), made by Him who has care of the community (again, God), and promulgated (they are made known, or knowable, to us through our natural inclinations). So although the precepts of the natural law ultimately derive their authority from God, they can be known independently of any knowledge of God—as Bradley puts it, they are “metaphysically theonomous” but “logically autonomous”)—and knowledge of them certainly does not require revelation.

Briefly setting out the inclinations and some of the precepts should illustrate this process of articulation, and at the same time give some indication of how it is connected with our pursuit of our final end. Like all things, we are naturally inclined toward our own good or perfection (good is that which all things seek), and thus as being is the first thing apprehended by reason simply, good is the first thing apprehended by reason as practical, or as directed toward action. And Aquinas takes it that, just as a grasp of the meaning of being and non-being leads naturally to knowledge of the principle of noncontradiction, so a grasp of good and evil leads to knowledge of the first principle of practical reason, good is to be done and pursued, and evil avoided: “All other precepts of the natural law are based upon this: so that whatever the practical reason naturally apprehends as man’s good (or evil) belongs to the precepts of the natural law as something to be done or avoided” (q94a2). And what do we naturally apprehend as good? Those things toward which we are naturally inclined, for good is an end and these are our ends by nature. Aquinas identifies three levels of these inclinations: That common to all substances (the inclination to continue to exist), that shared with other animals (inclinations to reproduce and to educate one’s offspring), and that proper to rational beings (to know the truth, ultimately about God, and to live in society). Phrases such as “and so forth” and “and other such things” occur in this passage, indicating that this is a quick overview rather than an exhaustive statement of the content of the natural law.

How are these inclinations articulated into precepts? This question might take the form of a procedural question concerning how we might move from an inclination to a norm (a version of the concern about moving from is to ought); this is addressed above (the inclinations are directives given by eternal reason—the natural law is a participation in the eternal law in the sense that our natural inclinations have their origin in God’s plan and creative action (q91a2)). But it might also take the substantive form of asking how we move from the inclinations mentioned to particular norms, and this needs to be explained. As we saw, Aquinas holds that as soon as we understand the meaning of the terms “good” and “evil,” we naturally understand that good is to be done and pursued and evil avoided—we have this knowledge by a “natural habit” he calls synderesis, (see q94a1ad2 and Iaq79a12). We know other things in this way too: That we are to fulfill our special obligations to others, and to do evil to no one—these are elucidations of the first principle, and from them flow a number of other principles, which have also been revealed to us in the Decalogue (see Ia-IIaeq100): The command to honor one’s parents functions as a paradigm for honoring one’s indebtedness in general; the commands forbidding murder, adultery, and theft speak to refraining from doing evil to others by deed; the commands forbidding false witness and coveting speak to refraining from doing evil by word or thought.

Aquinas is not as explicit as we might wish about how we acquire this knowledge, and there is some dispute here among commentators. One question is, must we acquire it at all? Does not Aquinas say that the principles grasped by synderesis are self-evident (if that is a good translation of per se nota)? The answer is that, yes, we must acquire it, for there is no innate knowledge; synderesis is a habit and so must be acquired. We do acquire it naturally, in this sense, that once we come to understand the terms employed in the principles, the principles are naturally known to be true. Experience and reflection are needed to grasp the meaning of such terms as good and evil, the proper objects of special obligations, the scope of non-maleficence. In this process our natural inclinations play a role: life, family, social life, and knowledge are good for each, and our social nature further directs us to attend to the common good and the good of our neighbor as well as our own private good. We might sketch the process as follows (although Aquinas never puts it quite this way): Good is to be done and evil avoided. So first, since good is to be done, and special obligations indicate goods owed to others, they are to be fulfilled. Second, since evil is to be avoided, it is to be done to no one (our social inclination here coming into play); we are naturally inclined to life, family, and society, so obtaining these things is good for each and losing them evil; thus murder, adultery, and so forth are evil and so not to be done.

In any event, once we have such principles in hand, as Aquinas takes it we all do, we have also in hand a way of evaluating whether we should allow our simple willings (such as, “how nice a Roman holiday would be”) to pass into intention—would it be good or evil to go now to Rome—is it consistent or otherwise with my flourishing as a rational creature? Would it for example violate any special obligation I am under, or perhaps require stealing? As said above, any proximate end an agent is considering whether to adopt may also be seen as a means to the agent’s final end, and its suitability as such may be judged by its accord with precepts of the natural law—these should serve, we may say, as penultimate major premises, under the first principle of practical reason, of any practical syllogism (or, when stated negatively, as a “filter” for all prospective means or proximate ends).

There is one major piece of the puzzle we have yet to deal with, the role of virtue in all of this. First, how exactly do these three, blessedness, law, and virtue, fit together? As indicated above, the natural law is a participation in the eternal law that resides primarily in our natural inclinations: the rational creature “has a share of the Eternal Reason, whereby it has a natural inclination to its proper act and end: and this participation of the eternal law in the rational creature is called the natural law” (q91a2). Our natural inclinations direct us toward our proper end, that is to say toward beatitudo, and the attainment of it is the fulfillment of our inclinations. But as we have also seen, our blessedness consists in virtuous activity (culminating in the loving contemplation of God). Such being the case, we should expect the natural law to direct us toward virtuous activity, and Aquinas does say explicitly that the natural law prescribes virtuous activity (q94a3, and see Pinckaers for an interesting development of the idea that the natural inclinations are the “seeds of the virtues,” into which they grow through the work of reason and habituation). So natural law, through informing our natural inclinations, provides the direction toward our final end, through the virtues as (constitutive) means to it.

Second, how does virtue play this role? We move toward our end through free, reasoned action, and cannot simply decide to grasp our final end. We must make a series of choices and carry them out, and it is here that virtue plays its principal role. One thing we clearly must do is reason well about how to act; we require excellence in practical reasoning. And that is to say we require prudence, which just is the virtue that applies right reason to action. But we also require the moral virtues such as justice and fortitude, which enable our knowledge of both the ends and means in practical reasoning. Aquinas is clear, as Aristotle was not, that we naturally know the ends we should pursue (this is the role of synderesis; see above, and also IIa-IIaeq47a6), but he also insists that we are rightly disposed toward that end by the moral virtues (Ia-IIaeq65a1)—the moral virtues safeguard us from “forgetting” our ends under the influence of vice, custom, or passion (q94a6)—fortitude, for instance, helps us control our fear of dangers so as to remain committed to the common good. The virtues also enable us to find the right means to the end. This is properly the work of prudence. Looking at how prudence does this work will clarify how the moral virtues play a supporting role in it. Aquinas says prudence has eight “quasi-integral parts” which can be classified as follows: Those that supply knowledge (memory and understanding or an intuitive grasp of the salient features of the present situation), those that acquire knowledge (docility and shrewdness), that which uses knowledge (reasoning, constructing the practical syllogism), and those that apply knowledge in command, the chief act of prudence (foresight directs present actions to the foreseen end, circumspection adjusts means to circumstances, and caution avoids obstacles to realizing the end). Prudence depends on the moral virtues not just to safeguard reason’s grasp of principles, but throughout its reasoning toward action. The parts of prudence just enumerated should make this clear: Docility, for example, requires humility. Also, the identification of the correct means to an intended end involves the understanding, or intuitive grasp, of the situation that helps supply the minor premise in a practical syllogism (see IIa-IIaeq49a2ad1). But this understanding can be corrupted by the intrusion of passion, as in cases of incontinence (Ia-IIaeq77a2), a state to which all are subject, unless fortified by the moral virtues (Fifi’s hopping impatiently on the bus although a cab would have been better presents a very mild case of such incontinence).

d. Final Comments

So for Aquinas practical reason is our capacity to discover how to move from our present situation toward the attainment of our final end. In successful practical reasoning, synderesis, prudence, and moral virtue work together to ensure that the action meets all of the criteria of a good action (q18aa1-4): suitability of object (what kind of action is this, borrowing or stealing?), due attention to circumstances (might frankness here and now be unduly embarrassing to one’s interlocutor?), and goodness of the end of action (is my goal in giving alms to impress a potential benefactor, or to succor the need of the less fortunate; ultimately, the end is good if and only if it is conducive to the agent’s final end). While practical reasoning presupposes our understanding of our final end as perfection, everything else in our practical lives, including our conception of our final end and to what extent we honor the principles grasped by synderesis, lies within its scope. When practical reasoning is done well leading to good action, the agent at one and the same time pursues her own perfection (the Aristotelian moment) and obeys the eternal law of God (the Augustinian)—the etymological connection between prudence and providence mirrors a metaphysical connection, for our practical reason participates in the eternal reason (q91a2; see also q19a10). Since our perfection is perfection as creatures, there is no tension between it and obedience—for Aquinas, practical reason is not torn between the fulfillment of obligation and the fulfillment of the agent.

3. Voluntarist Theory: Scotus

The reception of Aristotle and other non-Christian thinkers was never entirely easy, and worries about the influence of Greek and Arabic thought culminated, just after Aquinas’s death, in the Condemnations of 1277. In publishing them, the Bishop of Paris condemned 219 propositions drawn chiefly from Aristotle and his commentators, and while the principal target of these condemnations was the teaching of a “radical Aristotelianism” (or “Latin Averroism”) contrary to the Catholic faith by masters on the Faculty of Arts such as Siger of Brabant, a number of the condemned propositions were drawn from Aquinas’s work, although Aquinas was not named. In their wake the marriage between Greek and Biblical thought, between Aristotle and Augustine we might say, is a stormier one. Among the chief concerns of the Condemnations were divine and human freedom, and later thinkers were especially concerned to safeguard both. Many of them, rejecting Aquinas’s account of human freedom, found it necessary to portray the will itself as free. One way they did this was to stress the will’s independence from determination by nature, including the natural power of the intellect and the second nature imparted by virtues. The will was seen as free rather than as natural, and as nobler than the intellect—thus these thinkers are often called voluntarists.

John Duns Scotus (c. 1266-1308) is the most impressive and influential of the post-1277 thinkers, and his sharp break with eudaimonism in many ways anticipates modern moral theory, especially that of Kant. It should be noted, though, that even in making this break Scotus is working within the medieval tradition, drawing here especially on St. Anselm’s work On the Fall of the Devil; Scotus is also indebted to his Franciscan predecessors and fellow-travelers such as Henry of Ghent. The following presents some of the main lines of his account of practical reason, but readers should be aware that there are currently some major disputes over how to interpret Scotus; some of these will be mentioned, but readers are invited to consult the secondary sources mentioned for further information.

a. Freedom of the Will

Scotus emphasizes the freedom of the will in three key ways. The first two are rooted in his (characteristically voluntarist) teaching that the will is a self-mover rather than moved by anything else (an active rather than passive power); the third helps explain this capacity for self-movement. The first, then, lies in his emphasis on the dominance of the will over other powers, including the intellect. Just as in seeing we can focus on an object not in the center of our visual field, so in intellection the will can focus on and enjoy something other than what the intellect directly presents, and thus redirect the intellect (Opus Oxoniense II, dist. 42, qq1-4, nn. 10-11). The moral importance of this is that the will can turn aside from what the intellect presents as good and pursue something else (although that something else must be good in some respect). Second, he insists that in addition to being able to will or “nil” (velle or nolle), the will always retains the option simply to refrain from willing (non velle). This is important, for Scotus takes it that if we necessarily will something, we are not free. Scotus allows that the will is unable to nil beatitude, but holds that it can refrain from willing it, and so remains free (Ordinatio IV, suppl., dist. 49, qq9-10). This points up an important difference between his account and that of an intellectualist like Aquinas, who maintains that when the intellect has perfect vision of a perfect good (as it does only in the beatific vision), the intellect sees it as good, and the will adheres to that good, both from natural necessity. Scotus denies the necessity of willing the good presented by the intellect even here. The third point concerns his adoption of Anselm’s notion of the two affections of the will (which itself draws on Augustine’s account of the two loves of the will). The will’s tendency toward the agent’s perfection is called the affectio commodi, the natural appetite of the will that prohibits us from nilling perfection. It is similar to the will, simply, as it is understood by eudaimonist thinkers like Aquinas. See (Williams 1995) for an argument that it is identical to the will so understood; see (Toner 2005) for an argument that it is not. But it does not exhaust the will for Scotus, nor does it necessitate the willing of happiness, due to the affectio iustitiae, the tendency of the will to love things in accordance with their goodness, and not simply as means to or constituents of our own happiness. It is this affection, for Scotus, that grants the will its “native liberty.”

It also renders his account of practical reason more complicated, for now we see two distinct ways in which reason can present something as good to the will: First, something may be judged to be conducive to our happiness or perfection as rational agents (attracting the affectio commodi); second, something may be judged to be morally good or right or just (appealing to the affectio iustitiae). Thus, we can reason about how to attain happiness, or how to act justly. And although these will come together in our final union with God, they are always formally distinct and will often pull apart in this life. There is a hint here of what Sidgwick would much later call a dualism of practical reason, a dualism which in various forms characterizes most modern moral systems, Kantian or utilitarian. Scotus’ response to this situation also anticipates modern moral thinking (see Toner on this)—the pursuit of happiness must be moderated by justice; as Scotus puts it, the affection for justice acts as a “checkrein” (moderatrix) on the affection for happiness (Ordinatio II, dist. 6, q2). If the pursuit is not so moderated, it will be bad or at best morally indifferent. A crucial, and characteristically voluntarist, implication follows: Once the intellect has judged an act to be good (in either broad sense), the will remains free to follow the judgment or not, according to which affection it acts on. It may refuse to pursue a good conducive to happiness because doing so conflicts with a requirement of justice; it may turn from a good required by justice in order to pursue happiness instead (in the Ordinatio passage just cited, Scotus accounts for the sin of the angels along these lines). For better or worse, depending upon what one takes freedom to involve, Aquinas’s moderately intellectualist view that reason and will concur in free choice has been replaced by the voluntarist view that once reason has done its work, the will must independently make its free choice.

Here we touch on a controversial area. None of the voluntarists held that reason could be dispensed with, or was unimportant. At the least, reason must present options (and recommendations) to the will for it to be able to choose. Henry of Ghent had maintained that this was the extent of reason’s contribution to free choice (that it was merely a causa sine qua non—a necessary pre-condition of willing, but not properly a cause of it). Scotus at one point held a more moderate view, that reason served as a partial efficient cause of willing. Some Scotus scholars argue that he later moved further in the voluntarist direction, coming to accept something close to Henry’s view (or at least acknowledging it as an account just as persuasive as his own earlier view; see (Dumont 2001) for a detailed discussion). Whatever the correct view of Scotus’ mature position, however, the point about the will’s independence from reason should not be taken to be a denial of reason’s important role leading up to choice.

It would be an even greater mistake to think that, because Scotus is a voluntarist, he downplays reason’s contribution to choosing morally good actions. In fact, Scotus insists as firmly as Aquinas that to be morally good, an action must be willed in accordance with right reason (Quodlibet, q18). What does this involve for Scotus?

b. Synderesis, Conscience, and the Natural Law

Scotus follows tradition in invoking the notions of synderesis and conscience (Ordinatio II, dist. 39): Conscience is the habit of drawing the right conclusions about what is to be done by means of the practical syllogism. As such it depends upon knowledge of the first principles of practical reason, and synderesis is the habit of knowing these. What are they? Like Aquinas, Scotus takes them to be precepts of the natural law, but his handling of these precepts is quite different. His treatment of natural law makes no reference to natural inclinations—instead of being articulations of the directedness of human nature, the precepts are rules that are self-evident to reason because their denials lead to contradictions. For example, since good is the object of love and God is infinite goodness itself, the first principle of practical reason is that God is to be loved or, most strictly, God is not to be hated (Ordinatio III, suppl., dist. 37), for “goodness itself is to be hated” is self-contradictory. Scotus also relates the natural law to the Decalogue, and holds that from this first principle we may conclude that the precepts of the First Table (relating to God) follow and belong to the natural law strictly speaking. The precepts of the Second Table (relating to neighbor), however, belong to the natural law only broadly speaking—they are consonant with the principles known to be true analytically, but do not follow from them necessarily. In this passage, Scotus also distinguishes the precepts of the First and Second Tables, the precepts that belong to the natural law strictly and only broadly speaking, as follows: It is, in the abstract, possible for us to attain our final end of loving God without following the precepts of the Second Table (although not in the concrete, given that God actually has issued these commands), but is absolutely impossible for us to attain it while disobeying the precepts of the First. Thus, practical reason by itself is sufficient to tell us that if God exists, we must not hate Him, must have no other gods before Him. Scotus does not think we are left with theoretical possibilities and unaided practical reason—we know from Revelation that God has ordained the precepts of the Second Table, which are thus binding (for having been commanded, they move beyond being merely consonant with the love of God). Still, strictly speaking they are contingent and could be set aside or altered by God’s absolute power. Indeed Scotus thinks that in certain cases God has actually dispensed from them (see Ordinatio III, suppl., dist. 37; there is dispute among scholars as to how malleable the content of moral principles concerning love of neighbor is, and how open to rational investigation; see for example Wolter, Williams 1995, and Mohle’s contribution to Williams 2003).

To illustrate the relationship of consonance, Scotus gives us an example of the analogous relationship in positive law between “the principle of positive law,” that life in community should be peaceful, and secondary legal principles concerning private property. The institution of private property is not absolutely required to preserve peace, but given the infirmities of human nature, the common holding of property is likely to result in dispute and neglect. Thus allowing people to have their own possessions is “exceedingly consonant with peaceful living.” Likewise, although failing to love one’s neighbor is not strictly inconsistent with loving God (nor rejecting precepts stated in the Second Table strictly inconsistent with loving one’s neighbor), there is a harmony or consonance at both points (between love of God and neighbor, and between love of neighbor and honoring these precepts), for God has created us as social creatures and the precepts of the Second Table are conducive to social life. Although Scotus is not explicit, we may surmise that the principle that life in community ought to be peaceful belongs to the natural law in this broad sense, as peaceful life with God’s other rational creatures seems “exceedingly consonant” with love of God. As we will see, Scotus does explicitly say elsewhere that the “Silver Rule” belongs to the law of nature (broadly speaking). Prohibitions against murder, adultery, false witness and so forth follow from these pretty clearly, by way of consonance if not strict logical necessity.

So right practical reason begins from the precepts of the natural law, but how does it move to the judgment of conscience? Let us look at a case of deciding what to say when asked about one’s role in a certain affair, perhaps when lying might keep the agent out of some trouble. Scotus takes it that reason can grasp the wrongness of lying on the following basis: The Silver Rule, “Do not do to others what you would not want them to do to you,” is not only a commandment but a law of nature, at least in the broad sense; no one would want to be deceived by his neighbor; therefore, …. (Ordinatio III, suppl., dist. 38). With this principle in hand, how is one to act? It will depend on the particulars of the situation. The agent should now know that he should not deceive, but should tell the truth (or perhaps remain silent, if, say, the person asking is a gossip with no real stake in the matter; let us assume such is not the case). This much is clear from reason’s grasp of the principle and its understanding of the agent himself as a rational being, the action as speaking to another rational being, and the object as telling the truth (Scotus gives an example with the agent under the description of (rational) animal, the action as eating, and the object as nourishing food; Quodlibet, q18). But practical reason still has work to do: It must discern the right manner in which to tell the truth (say, calmly and straightforwardly rather than aggressively or evasively), and the right time and place (later in private, rather than now in company, say). Most importantly, it must place the act in service of a “worthy purpose,” direct it to an appropriate end (one that is just rather than merely advantageous—for acts that proceed solely from the affectio commodi will not be fully in accordance with right reason, since they focus only on the value of their objects to the agent, ignoring what intrinsic value they may have—thus Scotus holds that they are at best morally indifferent).

c. The Non-Teleological Character of Scotus’ Thought

Much of the detail above is similar to what Aquinas says about the moral goodness of action, which should not be surprising because both are drawing on Aristotle and Christian tradition, but there is an important difference as to the goodness of the ends of particular actions. Aquinas takes it that in intending, the will (and its proximate ends) should be ordered to the final end or highest good. This final end is the perfection of the agent, which itself consists in the right relation to God. In principle, the agent could articulate this ordering as a series of syllogisms in which practical reason clarified the way the pursuit of this proximate end is linked to the pursuit of the agent’s final end as set by her nature as a rational creature. A metaphorical way of putting this: Actions can be seen as episodes in a story that the agent, by means of her practical reason, is writing (or co-authoring, given God’s providential role). In the well-written story (the practically rational life blessed by grace), the episodes successfully lead up to the happy ending, in which the agent is united with her true love and, quite literally, lives happily ever after.

For Scotus, this teleological character largely (though not entirely) disappears. Actions must still be related to God, whom Scotus is happy to refer to as our final end. But now God in a way serves less as final end than as first cause, in the sense of author of the moral law or of dispensations from it; God is not so much sought after as an end, as honored and obeyed as source. At least in those actions that have creatures as their object (that is, most actions we perform in this life)—and which are therefore only contingently related to our attainment of God as our final end—practical reason does not identify the right way to act by discerning how the prospective actions contribute to a series leading up to the right relation to God (it does not construct a series of syllogisms in the way just mentioned). Instead, each prospective action is judged separately, as to whether it honors God appropriately, expresses love of God and obeys His commands (although such thoughts need not be always present in the agent’s mind). Actions may still be teleologically ordered, for a number of actions may be ordered to the accomplishment of a moral end. But it is no longer the case that all actions and their ends must be organized into a pattern or narrative completed only in the agent’s attainment of her final end, and that they can be fully assessed only in light of their place in such a pattern. Instead, each action (or course of action) stands alone as a complete work, and the ends of actions may be judged in light of their fit with the situation and their accord or discord with precepts of the natural law or other authoritative source (revealed commands, a divine dispensation). Picking up the author metaphor again, life is not so much a novel as a collection of epigrams and short stories, dedicated with love to God. This deep difference between Aquinas and Scotus is reflected in—indeed is a consequence of—their different formulations of the first principle of practical reason: “Good is to be done and pursued, and evil avoided” (Aquinas); “God is to be loved, and never hated” (Scotus). The one focuses on pursuit of the good (relationship with God); the other on the expression of love for God.

Related to this is Scotus’ reduced role for the moral virtues: He holds that prudence can exist without moral virtue, that as free we always have what we need to do the right action here and now; it need not be part of a larger pattern involving the development of character (Ordinatio III, suppl., dist. 36). Yet, Scotus has no wish to deny that the virtues are important: they can help turn the will from evil (the willing of which can blind the intellect to the truth by turning it away for a time), can help facilitate the will’s choosing in accordance with the right judgment of prudence, and can also help the act to be done in the right manner. Moral virtue assists us, then, both in reasoning about action and in making that reasoning effectively practical, but it is not essential to performing morally good actions.

d. Note on Ockham

Now it is perhaps these non-teleological aspects of Scotus’ thought, more than any other, that mark him out as a transitional figure. It is thus worth noting that it is concerning this feature of his thought that some of the disputes mentioned above are taking place. Williams (1995) and MacIntyre (1990) stress the role of obligation and divine commands in his theory; Hare and Ingham stress instead the role of love and the goal of relationship with God—views perhaps susceptible of some kind of teleological interpretation after all. However in the end Scotus should be read on this, it does seem fair to say, at the least, that divine commands, and the related notions of obligation and obedience, play a more prominent role in his thinking than they do in that of Aquinas.

And in any event, the later Franciscan William of Ockham will leave little doubt that he is a divine command theorist (but, see Osborne and the noted selections in Spade for a recent exchange on this). This does not mean that he is not concerned with practical reason; he still insists that the morally good action is the one dictated by right reason and willed because so dictated (Quodlibet IIIq15). But practical reason now operates within the framework of God’s ordained power, wholly constructed by God’s sovereign will. Knowledge of what God’s power has actually ordained, and thus of how we should act, is now even more dependent upon revelation; God could, by his absolute power, command us even to hate him, and it would then be right for us to do so. Here we have moved from Scotus’ moderate voluntarism to an extreme form in which morality consists in the obligation impressed by the commanding divine will upon the obedient (or otherwise) human will, and in which practical reason serves merely to help articulate what has been commanded and how to carry it out. The prevailing order, for Ockham, is one in which familiar concepts have application (prudence, the moral virtues, the Decalogue), but the radical contingency hanging about the whole is novel.

4. Medieval and Modern

This section briefly examines the influence of these two theorists on contemporary practical reasoning theory, and also explores the relation between their views of practical reason and some common positions in current debates (those between Generalists and Particularists, and between Internalists and Externalists).

a. The Current Influence of Aquinas and Scotus

The two figures focused on above are the two who seem most relevant to contemporary theorizing about practical reason. Aquinas’s influence is widespread: In Anglophonic moral philosophy Alasdair MacIntyre is perhaps the best-known among his many followers, developing Aquinas’s thought in ways more sensitive to the context of culture and tradition. Candace Vogler develops a broadly Thomistic theory of practical reason, exploring both his account of the capital vices and his division of the good into befitting, pleasurable, and useful (See (Toner 2005) for a short look at this division, and (Vogler 2002) for a very thorough treatment), concluding that in an atheistic context, it will be reasonable for some agents to be vicious. In general, the relevance of Aquinas’s thought as a development of Aristotle makes him a likely source for anyone working on practical reasoning or moral theory in this tradition, a fact not missed by some prominent moral theorists, most notably Philippa Foot and Rosalind Hursthouse. As for Scotus, his affinity with, and likely indirect influence upon, Kant, has been remarked by friends and foes alike (Williams and MacIntyre, for example). His direct influence on current thinking has not been great, but if the continuing progress on the critical edition of his works and the proliferation of Scotus scholarship are any indication, this may be beginning to change. In mainstream English philosophy, John Hare is perhaps the most prominent theorist so far to develop positions deeply indebted to Scotus. Scotus’ combination within his moral theory of deontological and virtue elements should make his thinking of interest to Kantian or other deontological theorists intent on appropriating broadly Aristotelian notions of virtue. Also, his subtle treatment of the relations between reason, divine and human freedom, and the absolute and ordained powers of God, should make him of great interest to contemporary divine command theorists (Hare provides one example of this).

b. The Medievals and Particularism

Turning to the first of the current debates concerning practical reason: Let generalism be the view that the presence of some features of action (say that it causes pleasure, or is unkind) always tends to make the action right (or wrong)—such features have invariable “deontic valence.” This may come in forms “thin” (some natural features of action, say conduciveness to pleasure, always have a positive valence) or “thick” (while there are no such natural features, there are certain thick features, like kindness or fairness or spitefulness, that have invariable valence). Particularism, then, is the denial of this. We may speak of thin or thick forms particularism, being denials of the corresponding forms of generalism (one may, then, be at the same time a thick generalist and thin particularist). Where do the medievals fall along this spectrum? They tend toward thick generalism, indeed, we might say toward thick absolutism, a form of generalism maintaining that there are some features of action that not only tend to make an action right or wrong, but always succeed in doing so. For Aquinas, for example, the fact that any action was vicious, or violated any precept of the natural law, would make it wrong. This is thick rather than thin generalism because the precepts have evaluative content that cannot be reduced to merely “natural” or thin terms (for example, while the precept against murder is certainly not just the claim that “wrongful killing is wrong,” it is the claim that “intentional killing of the innocent is wrong,” and “innocence” cannot be reduced to thin, non-evaluative language). For Scotus, things look quite similar, within the framework of God’s ordained power. But because dispensations are possible by God’s absolute power, the features picked out by natural law precepts relevant to the Second Table are not of invariable valence (that Isaac was innocent may actually tend to make sacrificing him right, given God’s command to Abraham). Still, there are some absolutes for Scotus, those pertaining to the love of God in the First Table. Ockham comes the closest to particularism, leaving just one feature of actions that has invariably positive valence, its having been commanded by God. Ockham also maintains that, when possible, loving God above all things is always right, subtly reconciling this with his claim that God could command us not to love Him (on the grounds that given such a command it would be impossible to love Him above all things; see Quodlibet IIIq14).

c. The Medievals and Internalism

Let us turn to reasons for action and their connection to motivation. Internalism comes in many forms, but common to them is the claim that if an agent has a reason to do some action A, she also has a motive to A (the denial of this—the assertion that an agent may have a reason to A but have no motive to A—is called “externalism”). One characteristic form of internalism, often referred to as “Humean,” is the claim that if R is a reason for S to do A, then A must serve some desire that S actually has. The medievals were not internalists in this sense. A Thomistic agent, for example, has a reason to pursue a good perfective of him even if he has no desire for it at present. But, does not the agent have another desire the good serves, namely for perfection? Actually no. It is the will that naturally aims at what is perfective of the agent, and the will is a power, not a standing desire. But the will is naturally inclined to pursue such goods, so perhaps a modified internalism, that cited not just actual but also counterfactual desires (the agent would desire it if suitably informed and so forth)? Perhaps so, but details aside, there is one more critical qualification to make: Although internalism strictly requires only a connection between reason and motivation, it is usually also held that the latter has priority, that the explanatory direction is from desire to reason for action. For Aquinas, the direction is instead from reason to desire (the various acts of reason serving as the formal causes of the corresponding acts of will). Allowing for this, and given careful specifications of the counterfactual conditions, Aquinas and other intellectualists could probably be brought under some fold or other of the big tent of internalism.

For Scotus and other (sometimes more thoroughgoing) voluntarists, things are harder to see. The relation between intellect and will is looser, but still it is not held that the will’s desiring something can create a reason for the agent to act; instead, reason serves as a sort of necessary condition of the will’s act of desire (as mentioned above, perhaps a partial efficient cause as Scotus held at one point, perhaps as a causa sine qua non as Henry of Ghent held and—some argue—Scotus later held). If the will is the total cause of its own willing, or at least the primary cause, it can refrain from willing in accordance with the judgment presented by right practical reason (recall Scotus’ point about non velle). Scotus even, following Anselm, performs a thought experiment concerning an angel created without the affectio iustitiae, maintaining that it could then only pursue its own happiness, and not what is intrinsically just. He does not explicitly say that it correctly identifies the right reasons for action, but given the independence of prudence from the moral virtues, it seems likely it could (“God is not to be hated” is, after all, supposed to be self-evidently true; and such an angel could understand the content of God’s revealed commands). If so, it could have reasons (not to hate God, not to commit or encourage lying or murder) with no corresponding desires (since it lacks the affectio iustitiae that would motivate it to follow these precepts even in cases in which doing so is not instrumental to its own happiness).

It is dangerous to sort philosophers according to distinctions they themselves do not have in mind (notice my hesitant language about Aquinas’s internalism above), but it seems that Scotus and other voluntarists would likely be externalists. This can be said more confidently—neither intellectualist nor voluntarist agents look much like the internalist and externalist agents one typically meets in the contemporary literature. But perhaps this is an advantage, for the medievals develop options largely ignored in much current discussion. And, it may be that the presence of more angels—falling, deformed, whole, and standing firm—would make for much livelier discussion.

5. Conclusion: Common Themes among the Medievals

So far this article has emphasized differences between the medieval accounts of practical reason, and their connections with some points in current theorizing. It is worth bringing out a few features that bring the medievals together while distinguishing them as a group from most current theorists. First, there is the shared Aristotelian and Augustinian heritage, already mentioned above. With this comes an agreement that our final end is the right relationship with God, a union with God by means of intellect and will. This is perfectly clear in intellectualists like Aquinas, but also holds for voluntarists. Scotus, for example, agrees that God is our final end; the initially open question is how to relate to Him: qua object of the affectio commodi (as the source of our perfection), or qua object of the affectio iustitiae (as perfect in Himself). And for all of the medievals, the good life consists in the successful attempt to achieve this union, to find, we might say, one’s proper place in Creation. In The City of God XIX.13, Augustine defines peace—our final end on his account—as the tranquillity of order, where order is the arrangement of things in which each finds its proper place in relation to the others, under God.

None of this is intended to paper over important differences, for example about just how to characterize that proper place, or whether the attempt to find it is best seen as a unified narrative or as a set of independent courses of action (whether life is a novel, we might say, or an anthology of short stories). It is intended only to stress the broad and important agreement underlying the differences in their accounts of practical reason. This is an agreement we should not find surprising given their shared belief, based on both philosophical argument and on faith, in a providential Creator, who is both Reason and Goodness. And it is an agreement whose importance we can recognize when we note that no medieval ever held that right practical reason could recommend an immoral course of action as, if Vogler is right, it can often do in an atheistic context.

6. References and Further Reason

a. Primary Sources

Anselm, On the Fall of the Devil, translated by Ralph McInerny in Anselm of Canterbury: The Major Works, edited by Brian Davies and Gillian Evans (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998).
Aristotle, The Nicomachean Ethics, translated by Terence Irwin (Indianapolis: Hackett Press, second edition 1999).
Aristotle, On the Soul, translated by J.A. Smith in The Complete Works of Aristotle, volume 1, edited by Jonathan Barnes (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984).
Aristotle, Metaphysics, translated by W.D. Ross in The Complete Works of Aristotle, volume 1, edited by Jonathan Barnes (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984).
Augustine, On Free Choice of the Will, translated by Thomas Williams (Indianapolis: Hackett Press, 1993).
Augustine, Confessions, translated by R.S. Pine-Coffin (London: Penguin Classics, 1961).
Augustine, The City of God against the Pagans, translated by R.W. Dyson (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998).
Henry of Ghent, Quodlibetal Questions on Free Will, translated by Roland Teske (Milwaukee: Marquette University Press, 1993).
Ockham (Occam), William of. Quodlibetal Questions, translated by Alfred Freddoso and Francis Kelley (New Haven: Yale University Press, 1998).
Scotus, John Duns. Duns Scotus on the Will and Morality, selections made and translated by Allan Wolter (Washington: The Catholic University of America Press, 1997).
- Many of Scotus’ writings are divided in much the way described below for Aquinas. One further subdivision often included in works commenting on Peter Lombard’s Sentences (such as Scotus’ Ordinatio), the distinctio, is noted as “dist.”
Thomas Aquinas, Summa theologiae, translated by the Fathers of the English Dominican Province (Allen, TX: Christian Classics, 1981).
- This work is divided into three parts, with the second itself sub-divided into two parts. The parts are further broken up into questions, and the questions into articles. The articles themselves comprise objections to the position Aquinas will take, a claim “to the contrary,” Aquinas’s argument for his position, and replies to the objections. Parts are customarily referred to as follows: Ia, IIa, IIIa (from the Latin prima, secunda, and tertia); the parts of the second part as Ia-IIae and IIa-IIae (from prima secundae and secunda secundae—first of the second, second of the second). Questions are denoted simply by “q,” articles by “a,” and replies to objections by “ad” or toward. If not otherwise noted, the reference is to the body of the article or corpus (“c”), Aquinas’s argument for his position. So for instance, Ia-IIaeq13a1ad3 refers to the first part of the second part, question 13, article 1, reply to the third objection.
Thomas Aquinas, Commentary on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics, translated by C.I. Litzinger (Notre Dame: Dumb Ox Books, 1993).

b. Secondary Sources

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Dumont, Stephen. “Did Duns Scotus Change His Mind on the Will?” in Nach der Verurteilung von 1277, edited by Jan Aersten, Kent Emery, and Andreas Speer (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 2001), 719-794.
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Hare, John. God’s Call (Grand Rapids: Eerdman’s, 2000).
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Ingham, Mary Beth and Mechthild Dreyer. The Philosophical Vision of John Duns Scotus (Washington: The Catholic University of America Press, 2004).
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MacDonald, Scott and Eleonore Stump. (editors), Aquinas’s Moral Theory: Essays in Honor of Norman Kretzmann (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1999).
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McCluskey, Colleen. “Medieval Theories of Free Will,” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
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- See especially the essays by King and McCord Adams.
Toner, Christopher. “Angelic Sin in Aquinas and Scotus and the Genesis of Some Central Objections to Contemporary Virtue Ethics,” The Thomist 69 (2005): 79-125.
Vogler, Candace. Reasonably Vicious (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2002).
Westberg, Daniel. Right Practical Reason (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1994).
Williams, Thomas. “How Scotus Separates Morality from Happiness,” American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 69 (1995), 425-445.
Williams, Thomas. (editor), The Cambridge Companion to Duns Scotus (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003).
- See especially the essays by Mohle, Williams, and Kent.
Wolter, Allan. “Native Freedom of the Will as a Key to the Ethics of Scotus” in The Philosophical Theology of John Duns Scotus, edited by Marilyn McCord Adams (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1990).

Author Information

Christopher Toner
Email: christopher.toner@stthomas.edu
University of St. Thomas
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy