Philosophy of African Diaspora Religions

This article explores philosophical ideas and concepts central to Afro-diasporic religions such as Vodou, Santeria, Candomblé, and Winti. Afro-diasporic religions have their origins in communities displaced by the Atlantic slave trade, blending elements from indigenous African traditions with Christian and original ideas.

Afro-diasporic religions have been largely overlooked in contemporary philosophy of religion, historically, dismissed as folklore, mythology or even satanic. This article, instead, delves into the intellectual depth of these traditions, which offer ideas that differ significantly from Abrahamic religious traditions and which challenge dominant views in contemporary Western philosophy of mind, epistemology and ethics.

The central ideas discussed include:

Afro-diasporic cosmology in which the universe contains material and spiritual realms existing along-side one each other, incorporating elements like Ashe (spiritual, divine energy).
Alternative conceptions of divinities, viewing gods as imperfect and capable of possessing adherents’ bodies during possession-episodes.
Tradition-specific sources of knowledge, such as divination and testimony during spirit-possession.
Afro-diasporic accounts of human personhood, viewing humans as composed of at least three elements: body, spirit, and soul.
Afro-diasporic ethics in which spirits and deities serve as moral exemplars and where evil is seen as inherent in reality, not as a distortion.

All ideas are discussed in detail and contrasted with alternative Western ideas.

Introduction
What Are Afro-diasporic Traditions?
Metaphysics
1. Cosmology
2. Ashé/ Axé/ Àṣẹ
Ontology
Epistemology
Philosophy of Mind
Ethics
Concluding Remarks
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Afro-diasporic religions are traditions that originated among descendants of Africans displaced by the Atlantic slave trade. These traditions are practiced primarily in the Caribbean, Northeast South America, Brazil and the Southern United States. Because of the prominent presence in the Caribbean, Afro-Diaspora religions are often called ‘Afro-Caribbean religions’. The term is, however, less inclusive of Brazilian and North American traditions. Traditions include Candomblé, Santería (also known as Lucumí), Vodou (Haitian, Dominican and New Orleans), Hoodoo (rootwork) and Winti. These traditions share similarities with African religious practices.

Despite their richness and uniqueness, Afro-diasporic traditions have received limited attention from contemporary philosophers. While there are some notable exceptions (Porcher and Carlucci 2023; Schmidt 2024; Porcher 2024)), these traditions have not been extensively explored philosophically. Most academic studies of these traditions are anthropological or psychological in nature, making it challenging to find systematic philosophical investigations of Afro-diasporic philosophy. The discussion below is based mainly on anthropological observations of practices and beliefs, as well as publications by practitioners.

2. What Are Afro-diasporic Traditions?

Distinguishing Afro-diasporic religions from other traditions poses some difficulties. Relying solely on geographical location is problematic because most traditions coexist with others like Christianity or Islam. Simply including traditions that originated as a result of the Atlantic slave trade raises issues as well. Slave communities also gave rise to new forms of Christianity or religious movements like Rastafari, which are not Afro-diasporic traditions. A better criterion is to include traditions shaped or grounded in a specific way of thinking or logic. Jonathan Chimakonam argues that African philosophy should be distinguished by its specific logico-methodological grounding. African logic includes basic axioma that differ from Western axioms (like the law of the excluded middle). These differences are especially noticeable in African divinatory practices (Chimakonam 2021; 2019: 138-148). Chimakonam’s criterion allows us to isolate philosophical traditions characterized by the African thought systems, differing from Asian or European thought systems. For our purposes, Chimakonam’s criterion can be applied with slight alterations. Afro-diasporic traditions have undergone syncretism to a greater extent than traditions on the African continent. Therefore, the thought system they are grounded in cannot simply be called ‘African’. Instead, Afro-diasporic traditions are characterized by a different way of thinking, which is somewhat closer to Western thought.

The Afro-diasporic thought system is arguably more aligned with the West. These traditions retained most central ideas and practices of their African parental traditions (e.g., divination practices, possession rituals, belief in multiple deities and spirits). Due to contact with Western ideas and traditions (mainly through colonialism and missionary efforts), they arguably became closer to Western ways of thinking. Other shared ideas among Afro-diasporic religions include beliefs about a spiritual realm populated by spirits and close personal contacts with these spirits.

Apart from a few exceptions, Afro-diasporic religions are not the majority religions in the regions where they are practiced. In the Americas, they coexist with various Christian churches and are actively opposed by some of them. Immigrant practitioners also form small communities in Europe, Asia, North America and Oceania.

Afro-diasporic religions typically rely on oral traditions and have very few written sources. They do not have sacred scriptures. The transmission of teachings and the initiation of clergy usually occur through apprenticeship. In some traditions, practices and beliefs are safeguarded by secret societies that maintain a high level of secrecy (Davis 2010). Most traditions are also open to new information regarding the nature of spirits and worship through open inspiration. New information can also be revealed through self-revelation during mediumship or possession.

All Afro-diasporic religions were heavily influenced by the Atlantic slave trade and the subsequent experiences of slavery. Enslaved individuals brought African traditions from various regions of Africa and continued to practice them, often in secret. Key African influences included Yoruba beliefs and practices, West African religious beliefs and practices and Kongo religious beliefs and practices. Due to the diverse origins of enslaved individuals from across Africa, different practices, pantheons and beliefs were merged or syncretized. Traces of this initial syncretism can be observed in the worship of various spirits.

African traditions were not only syncretized with each other but also influenced by Christian ideas. This influence stemmed from Christian missionaries in African homelands and forceful Christian indoctrination in the Americas. This syncretism is most evident in the use of Christian symbols such as the cross and the veneration or worship of Christian saints (Desmangles 2000). Some traditions even incorporated Catholic hymns or prayers into their rituals (Nwokocha 2023).

Reflection on Afro-diasporic traditions is largely absent in the philosophy of religion. The following discussion highlights some ideas central to these traditions that are of clear philosophical interest. As discussed below, some ideas are similar to Abrahamic ideas discussed in the philosophy of religion, while others are distinctly different.

3. Metaphysics

3a. Cosmology

Due to regional and cultural differences, Afro-diasporic traditions do not have a uniform worldview or cosmology. However, most traditions, however, do show stark similarities and shared ideas. The cosmology in Afro-diasporic traditions is heavily influence by Yoruba cosmology. According to Yoruba myths, all of reality has its origins in the god Olódùmarè. From him, other deities came forth, including the sky, the sun, moon and stars. The earth was formed by the creator god Ọbàtálá. He pleaded with the supreme god Olódùmarè to create dry land for living creatures to inhabit. Ọbàtálá created the earth with help from various other deities. He cultivated plants and formed hills and valleys. Later, Ọbàtálá decided to make humans to keep him company. After he created humans out of clay, Ọbàtálá asked Olódùmarè to breathe life into them (Wilson 1991). Variants of the creation myth exist as well, see (Gordon 1979; Porcher 2024). Some elements in the creation myths appear to be similar to the Genesis narrative. This may show the influence of Christian ideas on Yoruba cosmology. Nonetheless, the existence of a creator god who is different from the ultimate origin of reality is usually affirmed.

Like the Yoruba, adherents of Afro-diasporic traditions affirm that reality is not exhausted by the physical, perceivable reality. The Yoruba and their religious descendants represent their vision of the universe as similar to a calabash with two parts that form a whole. Like the calabash, reality is of one piece with both visible and invisible elements (Clark 2007) (Ann 2020). Invisible elements include various deities or spirits (called lwa, orishas or orixás) and forces of the universe (like ashé, see below).

While the perceivable reality is not the only reality, the invisible reality is not strictly separated from it. The boundaries between both realities are permeable. Invisible realities like spirits continuously interact with the visible. They can be accessed through ritual practices, both private and public (Ann 2020). Some practitioners of Candomblé describe the goal of ritual behavior as establishing harmony between the human and spiritual realms (Walker 1990). Most Afro-diasporic traditions also do not share the idea of an end time or final stage of history where a spiritual reality will supplant the physical reality we inhabit, as is the case in Abrahamic traditions.

3b. Ashé/ Axé/ Àṣẹ

An important concept in most Afro-diasporic traditions is that of ashé (axé in Candomblé and ashé in Santería). The concept traces back to Yoruba and is difficult to pin down. It is sometimes used to refer to the fundamental reality that makes up everything. Emmanuel Eze defines it as: “the principle of intelligibility in the universe and in humans (…) as rationality itself. It is creative power, the word, reason, the logos which ‘holds’ reality. More specifically, ashé is that principle which accounts for the uniqueness of humans; it is the rational and spiritual principle which confers upon humans their identity and destiny” (Eze 1998: 173). Schmidt defines it as “divine energy that pervades the universe and ensures creation” (Schmidt 2024). It may be a special kind of energy comparable to the Igbo concept of chi and the Chinese concept of qì. Some define it as “a sacred, mystical or invisible force that transcends human beings” (Da Silva and Brumana 2017). Ashé is believed to be a force that circulates among all beings. Ashé is also regarded as creative energy without which spirits and humans are not able to create or transform (Mandle, Rothschild, and others 1992) quoted by (Schmidt 2024). Human subjects ought to seek balance of ashé through proper ways of living and ritual behavior. The pure experience of ashé is said to only be achievable during trance (Schmidt 2024).

Although the concept remains somewhat vague, it seems as if ashé is primordial energy that makes up most of reality. Sometimes the breath of life by the god Olódùmarè is seen as an infusion of ashé. It can take different forms that may be exchanged among beings. Balancing ashé is key for maintaining well-being (Schmidt 2024). Offerings are a means for the transmission of ashé. When consuming offerings of food, spirits do not consume the physical food but rather the ashé present in the food (Schmidt 2024). This suggests that interaction between humans and spirits is partly an exchange of ashé.

Ashé is a key part of reality in most Afro-diasporic traditions. Its existence has a key role in rituals and other religious practices and serves as a bridge between the human and non-human realms. The existence of Ashé is without counterpart in western cosmology but bears similarities to concepts in other Non-Western traditions.

4. Ontology

Most Afro-diasporic traditions acknowledge the existence of a transcendent ultimate origin of reality, known by various names such as Olódùmarè, Elédùmarè, Bondye, Anana, and others. In these traditions, the ultimate god typically plays a minor role in religious practices and the lives of followers. Some believe this is because the ultimate god is too transcendent for humans to access. This transcendent god is the only one with the power to give life and all other spirits or deities rely on him for their existence and sustenance.

Non-ultimate deities or spirits are more prominent in religious practices. It is difficult to pinpoint how many spirits are worshipped in each tradition. Some suggest that the number may be lower than in African traditions due to lost knowledge from forced migration. The number is intentionally kept vague as a sign of humility or ignorance on the part of practitioners. For instance, followers of Haitian Vodou may claim to worship 400 + 1 spirits, with the ‘plus one’ referring to additional spirits that could be added over time.

The deities or spirits govern different natural domains (Richman 2019), often reflecting Yoruba influences in their names. Most traditions have spirits overseeing love or protection, as well as facilitating access to the spirit-world through rituals or offerings, allowing practitioners access (Legba in Haitian Vodou, Eleguá in Cuban Santería). Spirits are honored through prayer and offerings.

Spirits form different strands or nations in most Afro-diasporic traditions. For example, Haitian Vodou distinguishes 21 nations of spirits of which the Rada, Petro and Congo nations are the most worshipped (Hebblethwaite 2021). Surinam Winti also knows different groups of spirits (Luzaragga 2019). Candomblé distinguishes nations of spirits as well. Most adherents either worship spirits from the Jêje-Nago lineage or the Congo-Angola lineage. The former likely traces back to spirits worshipped in West-Africa and the latter to spirits worshipped in the Congo Basin. Adherents of both groups tend to have minor differences in ritual activity. For example, the Congo-Angola rite plays drums with hands rather than sticks and sings hymns in Portuguese (Da Silva and Brumana 2017). Some of these nations trace back to different geographical origins and are the result of syncretism. Spirits of the same nation tend to have similar properties as well. Spirits of the Petro nation in Haitian Vodou are regarded as ‘hot’; meaning they are easily ill-tempered and even considered dangerous to work with. Spirits of the Rada nation, by contrast are considered ‘cool’. They are considered easier and less dangerous to petition.

Most deities and spirits are not attributed with omni-properties (omniscience, omnibenevolence or omnipresence) commonly attributed to God in Abrahamic traditions. They are usually bound by cosmic laws such as cause and effect or moral laws. Some also have a morally ambiguous nature, being both inclined to heal or help and to curse or cause harm. For example, an adherent of Vodou lwa Baron Samedi noted: “[I]f he is paid to do bad things, he’ll do it (…) but if you are a good child, and you serve him well (…) he’ll do anything for you” (Marcelin 1950: 168) quoted by (Hebblethwaite 2021: 190).

Spirits and most deities are not omnipresent and usually come when invited. Some inhabit specific trees or places of worship (Landry 2016) or only become present when invoked. Another perfection spirits lack is aseity (i.e. being self-sufficient) (see (Craig 2016). Spirits require sustenance from humans in the form of offerings or devotion. As a result, the relationship between humans and the supernatural is much more reciprocal than in Abrahamic traditions.

Another difference between deities and spirits worshipped in Afro-diasporic traditions and God in Abrahamic traditions is that they show strong preferences. Spirits can have preferences for some people over others (usually those that show reverence). They also show preference for worldly goods. The lwa of Haitian Vodou shows strong preferences for specific offerings, garments or colors. For example, lwa Danbala shows a strong preference for white attire. Worshippers wearing white are more likely to be possessed by Dambala or be granted favors (Nwokocha 2023). Similar preferences can be noted in Santería and Candomblé. Spirits also show a preference for musical rhythms and dance (Bahia 2016).

Most, if not all, Afro-diasporic traditions actively practice spirit possession. During possession, a spirit takes over a human’s bodily and behavioral functions. The possessed human is usually not aware of the spirit and has no memories of the episode, although there are exceptions (See (Bourguignon 2005)). Possession usually involves typical bodily reactions like shaking, thermic reactions and rolling of the eyes. Spirit possession is only known in Abrahamic traditions as demonic possession and has an exclusively negative connotation. In Afro-diasporic traditions, spirit possession can be malevolent but is usually regarded as good. It allows intimate connection to spirits and provides venues for help or advice from spirits.

Spirit possession is similar to shamanistic practices where subjects seek contact with spirits (Eliade 2024). However, there are important differences. In most shamanic practices, the subject reaches out into the spirit world and travels towards the spirits. The shamanic journey can involve elements like soul flights or astral travel. Spirit possession involves reverse movement. The subject invites the spirits to come down into her body and temporary take over her functions (Hebblethwaite 2021).

Spirit possession rituals often involve inviting spirits by making offerings and wearing suitable attire. Spirits are also welcomed by music, singing and dancing (Nwokocha 2023). Spirit possession is facilitated by ecstatic rituals that make humans prone to trance states (Hebblethwaite 2021). Spirits choose the best dancer or person otherwise deemed most suitable to host the spirit. When a spirit takes over a human body, it is greeted with the utmost respect and asked for blessings or favors.

Spirit possession presents a solution to a widely discussed problem in Western philosophy of religion. In the West, some have noted a problem with divine intervention. Since God is regarded as a transcendent, purely non-physical being of a profoundly different nature, interaction with the physical world (including physical humans) would be problematic. Various solutions to this problem have been proposed (Moser 2022). Spirit possession offers a way towards a solution. During spirit possession, spirits take control over humans. Haitian Vodou holds that a human’s ti bon ange temporarily gets replaced with a spirit’s (see also below). Spirits thus take control over a human’s functions in a similar way as a human mind takes control over a body. Interaction between a spirit and human during possession is, therefore, similar to mind-body interaction. Mind-body interaction has been problematized as well. Interactions between minds and bodies are, however, less mysterious than interactions between a transcendent God and a physical world. Minds and bodies may be of different nature or substances, but one is not highly transcendent or radically different from the other.

5. Epistemology

Afro-diasporic epistemology lacks a systematic discussion on the definitions of knowledge or detailed criteria for justification, which are common in Western epistemology. It also does not extensively discuss the justification of belief in God or spirits (for such a discussion, refer to Van Eyghen 2023). However, these traditions have specific ways of understanding the nature and will of spirits, typically through divination and possession.

The significance of divination highlights the African roots of Afro-diasporic religions. While all traditions incorporate forms of divination, they are usually less complex than those found in their African origins. Divination practices aim to receive messages or information from spirits which can be communicated through dreams (Nwokocha 2023), intuition or material means. The central practices and goals of divination are similar in Afro-diasporic traditions. Adherents contemplate a question, perform some actions (for example, throwing cowry shells or sticks) and interpret the outcome of the action (e.g. how many cowry shells face upwards or what pattern the sticks form). The outcome may indicate a positive or negative answer or provide more details. Sometimes, the divinatory action is repeated several times (Da Silva and Brumana 2017).

Divination is often used to address practical questions, such as suitability of a romantic partner or how to cure an illness, as well as spiritual matters like discovering one’s Met tet in Haitian Vodou or finding out what curses haunt one.

It is evident that divination differs from testimony as it requires special skills and interpretation. Testimony (at least as commonly discussed in Western epistemology) is a direct transmission of information from subject to subject and usually does not require special skills or interpretation. Divination is also not mere interpretation; it is more of a technological application, involving careful consideration and use of background information. It requires considerable skill but is less idiosyncratic.

Divination is commonly not regarded as an infallible source of knowledge. Answers gained by divination may turn out to be false or predictions may not come true. Some attribute mistakes to errors in interpreting the signs since the replies are often abstract (Nwokocha 2023). Some are open to the possibility that spirits may trick or deceive during divination. Many other sources of knowledge, like testimony, perception and reasoning are not infallible as well. Adherents of Afro-diasporic traditions do add that divination requires considerably more expertise than other sources of knowledge. It is nonetheless usually regarded as reliable.

Another source of knowledge characteristic of Afro-diasporic traditions is through possession. Many traditions hold rituals where spirits are invited in to temporarily take control of a subject’s body and functions. Possession can also occur spontaneously outside of ritual settings. Possession serves many functions besides gaining knowledge. However, possessing spirits are often consulted for practical advice or other matters.

Information obtained during possession is believed to be directly communicated by the possessing spirit or deity, akin to Western divine revelation. However, possessing spirits are not seen as omniscient and the knowledge gained is often practical and contextualized. Unlike Western revelations that focus on spiritual or moral matters, knowledge from possessing spirits tends to be more practical in nature.

6. Philosophy of Mind

We have observed how followers of Haitian Vodou believe that a person’s ti bon ange is temporarily replaced during possession episodes. This presents a view of the human person that differs from Western perspectives. While most Western views identify one or two fundamental parts or substances within a human person (matter or physicality for physicalists and matter or physicality combined with a mental substance or soul for dualists), some Afro-diasporic traditions identify at least three.

According to Haitian Vodou, a human person is composed of a body, a ti bon ange and a gros bon ange. The Vodou concept of the body aligns with Western understanding and refers to human corporality along with basic motor functions. The gros bon ange or big guardian angel is the life force shared by all humans. It can be seen as a specific form of the general ashé. The gros bon ange is not individualized and returns to the ultimate god after death. The ti bon ange (small guardian angel) is the individualizing aspect of the human person. The ti bon ange is believed to leave the body during dreams and possession episodes. During possession, the ti bon ange is replaced by a deity or spirit (Métraux 1946). Additionally, humans have a met tet (master of the head), a tutelary spirit that is closely connected to the individual and offers guidance and protection. The met tet guides and protects the subject, in some ways similar to the western concept of a guardian angel although the met tet also poses demands on humans. The identity of the met tet can be revealed through divination (Strongman 2008).

Followers of Surinam Winti also believe in a personal tutelary spirit or winti that guides them through life (Luzaragga 2019). Adherents of Candomblé believe that humans consist of three elements that need to be balanced: a physical body that perishes with biological death, breathi or emi which gives life, intelligence or consciousness (ori), and a divine element or spark. The divine element connects humans to the orixás. During initiation rituals, the orixá is firmly placed within the body of the initiate to achieve better harmony with the divine element (Schmidt 2024).

Candomblé shares the Haitian belief in a tutelary deity or spirit with all humans having a connection to one or more orixá (Serra 2019). Initiation strengthens the bond with one’s personal orixá and adherents believe that each individual has a predetermined plan or odu before birth. Odus guide individuals through different life phases, with efforts made to align with the child’s odu from birth to avoid misfortunes. Odus also govern animals, spaces and events (Da Silva and Brumana 2017).

While Afro-diasporic traditions recognize various non-bodily elements in human persons, they emphasize the importance of the body more than Western traditions. Ritual practices involve bodily behavior, like dancing, singing, shaking and drumming to a greater extent (Porcher and Carlucci 2023). Interaction with spirits through possession is a physical experience rather than a purely mental one. Many traditions also place significance on bodily purity.

7. Ethics

Afro-diasporic traditions lack a formalized moral code or systematic reflection on ethics. Ethical norms are typically based on tradition and customs (Clark 2005). Rules in these traditions often have a stronger communal focus, emphasizing obligations to the wider family and community. A common theme is the respect for elders and their guidance, both in ritual and practical matters (Mason 2002). This respect is reinforced by honoring ancestral spirits like the Egún in Cuban Santería, which are also significant in Haitian Vodou and Candomblé.

Similar to Western religious traditions, Afro-diasporic traditions believe that morality is derived from a cosmological order. Some rules are rooted in mythological stories about spirits. For example, a Cuban myth tells of Eleguá and Obatalá punishing a king for his pride and mistreatment of the poor (Olmos and Paravisini-Gebert 2022). Adherents do not attribute the origin of morality to God’s nature, will or commandments as in Abrahamic traditions but they do believe that spirits play an active role in guiding morality, sometimes appearing in dreams to offer moral guidance (Mason 2002: chapter 8).

Unlike many other traditions, Afro-diasporic traditions do not view evil as an aberration but as an integral part of the cosmological order. Some believe that committing evil serves a balancing purpose and restores order. Spirits may facilitate evil by assisting in curses or seeking revenge on behalf of practitioners (Davis 2010). However, the emphasis on curses in these traditions is often exaggerated.

Certain practices in Afro-diasporic traditions may involve socially transgressive or unacceptable activities such as the Guédé cult in Haitian Vodou which includes sexually suggestive displays and use of human remains (Hebblethwaite 2021). Rituals centered around Exu and Pomba Gira in Quimbanda exhibit similar characteristics and are more popular among marginalized segments of society.

In some Afro-diasporic traditions, ritual behavior can positively impact morality. In Cuban Santería, having a ‘good heart’ can enhance moral character and disposition. Practitioners describe a good heart as ‘clean’ and ‘disinterested’, leading to increased generosity towards others and the spirits. Developing a god heart involves proper ritual observance and allowing the spirits to influence one’s life (Mason 2002).

In Haitian Vodou, spirits (lwa) serve as guides, embodying virtues like courage (Ogun) or parental care (Ezili Danto). Through exposure to these spirits and their rituals, individuals are encouraged to emulate their virtues. Some spirits represent qualities associated with freedom or independence, especially of divinized ancestors who played a role in the Haitian revolution (Hebblethwaite 2021).

Certain moral rules apply to specific worshippers such as those who are initiated or have a closer connection to a spirit. In Haitian Vodou, some practitioners are spiritually married to a spirit, requiring them to show increased reverence and adhere to stricter rules, such as abstaining from alcohol, meat or sex for periods of time (Nwokocha 2023). While spirit marriages are unique to these traditions, initiates often follow more stringent guidelines (Van Eijk 2010).

8. Concluding Remarks

Afro-diasporic traditions have a rich history and a complex system of ideas, most of which are intertwined with religious beliefs and are distinct from Western ideologies. Reflection on metaphysical, epistemological and ethical concepts dates back centuries and continues to shape the lives of those who practice these traditions.

Despite the depth and significance of ideas from Afro-diasporic traditions, they have had minimal impact on Western academic discourse, particularly within the realm of philosophical discussions. This lack of influence may be attributed to stereotypical portrayals of these traditions in popular culture and society, as well as a general lack of awareness. However, as demonstrated in the preceding discussion, Afro-diasporic traditions offer unique perspectives that could enrich existing philosophical dialogues. These traditions present differing viewpoints on the nature of deities and humans, with less variation in epistemology and ethics, though most Afro-diasporic traditions draw from additional sources for both.

9. References and Further Reading

Bahia, Joana. 2016. “Dancing with the Orixás: Music, Body and the Circulation of African Candomblé Symbols in Germany.” African Diaspora 9 (1–2): 15–38.
A discussion of bodily postures and other ways the body influences Candomblé rituals.
Bourguignon, Erika. 2005. “Spirit Possession.” In A Companion to Psychological Anthropology: Modernity and Psychocultural Change, edited by Casey Conerly and Robert Edgerton, 374–87. Conerly Casey, Robert B. Edgerton. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing ltd.
In depth discussion of spirit possession across cultures, with attention for psychological and social factors.
Chimakonam, Jonathan O. 2019. Ezumezu: A System of Logic for African Philosophy and Studies. Cham: Springer.
Discussion of African systems of logic and its differences to Western logic. Also discusses how African logic can tie various African traditions together.
Chimakonam, Jonathan O. 2021. “On the System of Conversational Thinking: An Overview.” Arumaruka: Journal of Conversational Thinking 1 (1): 1–46.
Discussion of how African logic is rooted in different modes of thinking.
Clark, Mary Ann. 2005. Where Men Are Wives And Mothers Rule: Santería Ritual Practices and Their Gender Implications. Gainesville: University Press of Florida.
Book about gender differences and their implications in Santería ritual practices.
Clark, Mary Ann. Santeria: Correcting the myths and uncovering the realities of a growing religion. Bloomsbury Publishing USA, 2007.
Introduction to the central ideas of Santeriá.
Craig, William Lane. 2016. God over All: Divine Aseity and the Challenge of Platonism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Book with arguments for divine aseity over and against alternative conceptions of the divine.
Da Silva, Vagner Gonçalves, and Fernando Giobellina Brumana. 2017. “Candomblé: Religion, World Vision and Experience.” In Handbook of Contemporary Religions in Brazil, 170–85. Leiden: Brill.
Introduction to the main features of Candomblé.
Davis, Wade. 2010. The Serpent and the Rainbow. New York: Simon and Schuster.
Personal account of the author’s quest for the ‘Zombie Powder’ in Haitian Vodou. The account contains an in-depth discussion of secret societies within Haitian Vodou.
Desmangles, Leslie G. 2000. The Faces of the Gods: Vodou and Roman Catholicism in Haiti. Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina Press.
Introduction to central ideas in Haitian Vodou with focus on syncretism with Roman Catholicism.
Eliade, Mircea. 2024. Shamanism: Archaic Techniques of Ecstasy. Princeton NJ: Princeton University Press.
Reprint of Eliade’s classical account of shamanism. The book is an in-depth discussion of various recurring features across traditions with a large number of examples.
Eze, E Chukwudi. 1998. “The Problem of Knowledge in ‘Divination’: The Example of Ifa.” In African Philosophy: An Anthology, edited by E. Chukwudi Eze, 173–75. Oxford: Blackwell.
Discussion of Ifa divination in Yoruba with a discussion of Ashe.
Gordon, Jacob U. 1979. “Yoruba Cosmology and Culture in Brazil: A Study of African Survivals in the New World.” Journal of Black Studies 9 (4): 231–44.
Account of how Yoruba ideas feature in Brazilian traditions like Candomblé and Umbanda.
Hebblethwaite, Benjamin. 2021. A Transatlantic History of Haitian Vodou: Rasin Figuier, Rasin Bwa Kayiman, and the Rada and Gede Rites. Jackson: University Press of Mississippi.
Detailed account of the African roots of Haitian Vodou. Also contains a discussion of Haitian songs that features in Vodou rituals.
Hurston, Zora Neale. 1990. Tell My Horse. Voodoo and Life in Haiti and Jamaica. Harper perennial.
Anthropological study conducted by the author in the 1930’s in Haiti and Jamaica. The work is well known for its vivid description of possession rituals.
Landry, Timothy R. 2016. “Incarnating Spirits, Composing Shrines, and Cooking Divine Power in Vodun.” Material Religion 12 (1): 50–73.
Discussion of how materials like food are used in West-African rituals.
Luzaragga, Ramon. 2019. “Suriname.” In Encyclopedia of Latin American Religions, edited by Henri Gooren, 1519–23. Religions of the World. Cham: Springer.
Introduction to the religious traditions present in Surinam. Contains a discussion of Winti.
Mandle, Julia Barnes, Deborah Menaker Rothschild, and others. 1992. Sites of Recollection: Four Altars & a Rap Opera. Philadelphia: ‎ University of Pennsylvania Press.
Marcelin, Milo. 1950. Mythologie Vodou (Rite Arada II). Port au Prince: Editions Haitiennes.
Collection of Haitian Vodou myths.
Mason, Michael Atwood. 2002. Living Santería: Rituals and Experiences in an Afro-Cuban Religion. Smithsonian Institution.
Anthropological study of Santería. Contains the author’s account of his own initiation.
Métraux, Alfred. 1946. “The Concept of Soul in Haitian Vodu.” Southwestern Journal of Anthropology 2 (1): 84–92.
Discussion of the tri-partite division of the human soul in Haitian Vodou.
Moser, Paul K. 2022. “Faith, Power, and Philosophy: Divine-Human Interaction Reclaimed.” International Journal of Philosophy and Theology 83 (4): 281–95.
Philosophical account of how human-divine interaction can occur in Abrahamic traditions.
Nwokocha, Eziaku Atuama. 2023. Vodou En Vogue: Fashioning Black Divinities in Haiti and the United States. Chapel Hill: UNC Press Books.
Anthropological study of Haitian Vodou rituals with focus on the use of clothing to embody Vodou deities.
Olmos, Margarite Fernández, and Lizabeth Paravisini-Gebert. 2022. Creole Religions of the Caribbean: An Introduction from Vodou and Santería to Obeah and Espiritismo. New York: NYU Press.
Introduction to some Afro-diasporic traditions.
Porcher, José Eduardo. 2024. Afro-Brazilian Religions. Cambridge Elements. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Introduction to key philosophical ideas in Afro-Brazilian religions, centered around Candomblé, with a focus on the role of mythology, possession-experiences and embodied knowledge.
Porcher, José Eduardo, and Fernando Carlucci. 2023. “Afro-Brazilian Religions and the Prospects for a Philosophy of Religious Practice.” Religions 14 (2): 146.
Discussion of how Candomblé rituals are much more embodied or have a stronger bodily element than Western traditions.
Richman, Karen. 2019. “Vodou, Voodoo.” In Encyclopedia of Latin American Religions, edited by Henri Gooren, 1618–24. Religions of the World. Cham: Springer.
Introduction to Haitian Vodou.
Rigaud, Milo. 1985. Secrets of Voodoo. City Lights Books.
Classical summary of central ideas in Haitian Vodou.
Schmidt, Bettina E. 2024. “Axé as the Cornerstone of Candomblé Philosophy and Its Significance for an Understanding of Well-Being (Bem Estar).” Religious Studies, 1–13.
Discussion of axé in Brazilian Candomblé as the philosophical backbone of the tradition.
Serra, Ordep. 2019. “Candomblé.” In Encyclopedia of Latin American Religions, edited by Henri Gooren, 270–78. Religions of the World. Cham: Springer.
Introduction to Candomblé.
Strongman, Roberto. 2008. “Transcorporeality in Vodou.” Journal of Haitian Studies, 4–29.
Discussion of possession in Haitian Vodou with focus on its bodily features.
Van Eijk, Femke. 2010. “Delicate Matters: How Candomblé Food Habits Reflect Identity Dynamics.” Leiden: Leiden University. https://www.ascleiden.nl/Pdf/thesis-vaneijk.pdf.
Account of research on use of food in Candomblé offerings and feasts.
Van Eyghen, Hans. 2023. The Epistemology of Spirit Beliefs. Taylor & Francis.
Arguments for the justification of belief in spirits.
Walker, Sheila S. 1990. “Everyday and Esoteric Reality in the Afro-Brazilian Candomblé.” History of Religions 30 (2): 103–28.
Discussion of different realms of existence in Candomblé.
Wilson, Kathleen Atkins. 1991. The Origin of Life on Earth: An African Creation Myth. Mt. Airy, MD.: Sights Productions.
Version of Yoruba creation story.

Author Information

Hans Van Eyghen
Email: H.M.R.A.VanEyghen@tilburguniversity.edu
Tilburg University
The Netherlands

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy