Anaximander (c. 610—546 B.C.E.)

Anaximander was the author of the first surviving lines of Western philosophy. He speculated and argued about “the Boundless” as the origin of all that is. He also worked on the fields of what we now call geography and biology. Moreover, Anaximander was the first speculative astronomer. He originated the world-picture of the open universe, which replaced the closed universe of the celestial vault.

His work will always remain truncated, like the mutilated and decapitated statue that has been found at the market-place of Miletus and that bears his name. Nevertheless, by what we know of him, we may say that he was one of the greatest minds that ever lived. By speculating and arguing about the “Boundless” he was the first metaphysician. By drawing a map of the world he was the first geographer. But above all, by boldly speculating about the universe he broke with the ancient image of the celestial vault and became the discoverer of the Western world-picture.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Sources
2. The “Boundless” as Principle
3. The Arguments Regarding the Boundless
   1. The Boundless has No Origin
   2. The Origin must be Boundless
   3. The “Long Since” Argument
4. The Fragment
5. The Origin of the Cosmos
6. Astronomy
   1. Speculative Astronomy
   2. The Celestial Bodies Make Full Circles
   3. The Earth Floats Unsupported in Space
   4. Why the Earth Does Not Fall
   5. The Celestial Bodies Lie Behind One Another
   6. The Order of the Celestial Bodies
   7. The Celestial Bodies as Wheels
   8. The Distances of the Celestial Bodies
   9. A Representation of Anaximander’s Universe
7. Map of the World
8. Biology
9. Conclusion
10. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Sources

The history of written Greek philosophy starts with Anaximander of Miletus in Asia Minor, a fellow-citizen of Thales. He was the first who dared to write a treatise in prose, which has been called traditionally On Nature. This book has been lost, although it probably was available in the library of the Lyceum at the times of Aristotle and his successor Theophrastus. It is said that Apollodorus, in the second century BCE, stumbled upon a copy of it, perhaps in the famous library of Alexandria. Recently, evidence has appeared that it was part of the collection of the library of Taormina in Sicily, where a fragment of a catalogue has been found, on which Anaximander’s name can be read. Only one fragment of the book has come down to us, quoted by Simplicius (after Theophrastus), in the sixth century AD. It is perhaps the most famous and most discussed phrase in the history of philosophy.

We also know very little of Anaximander’s life. He is said to have led a mission that founded a colony called Apollonia on the coast of the Black Sea. He also probably introduced the gnomon (a perpendicular sun-dial) into Greece and erected one in Sparta. So he seems to have been a much-traveled man, which is not astonishing, as the Milesians were known to be audacious sailors. It is also reported that he displayed solemn manners and wore pompous garments. Most of the information on Anaximander comes from Aristotle and his pupil Theophrastus, whose book on the history of philosophy was used, excerpted, and quoted by many other authors, the so-called doxographers, before it was lost. Sometimes, in these texts words or expressions appear that can with some certainty be ascribed to Anaximander himself. Relatively many testimonies, approximately one third of them, have to do with astronomical and cosmological questions. Hermann Diels and Walter Kranz have edited the doxography (A) and the existing texts (B) of the Presocratic philosophers in Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker, Berlin 1951-1952⁶. (A quotation like “DK 12A17” means: “Diels/Kranz, Anaximander, doxographical report no.17”).

2. The “Boundless” as Principle

According to Aristotle and Theophrastus, the first Greek philosophers were looking for the “origin” or “principle” (the Greek word “archê” has both meanings) of all things. Anaximander is said to have identified it with “the Boundless” or “the Unlimited” (Greek: “apeiron,” that is, “that which has no boundaries”). Already in ancient times, it is complained that Anaximander did not explain what he meant by “the Boundless.” More recently, authors have disputed whether the Boundless should be interpreted as spatially or temporarily without limits, or perhaps as that which has no qualifications, or as that which is inexhaustible. Some scholars have even defended the meaning “that which is not experienced,” by relating the Greek word “apeiron” not to “peras” (“boundary,” “limit”), but to “perao” (“to experience,” “to apperceive”). The suggestion, however, is almost irresistible that Greek philosophy, by making the Boundless into the principle of all things, has started on a high level of abstraction. On the other hand, some have pointed out that this use of “apeiron” is atypical for Greek thought, which was occupied with limit, symmetry and harmony. The Pythagoreans placed the boundless (the “apeiron”) on the list of negative things, and for Aristotle, too, perfection became aligned with limit (Greek: “peras”), and thus “apeiron” with imperfection. Therefore, some authors suspect eastern (Iranian) influence on Anaximander’s ideas.

3. The Arguments Regarding the Boundless

It seems that Anaximander not only put forward the thesis that the Boundless is the principle, but also tried to argue for it. We might say that he was the first who made use of philosophical arguments. Anaximander’s arguments have come down to us in the disguise of Aristotelian jargon. Therefore, any reconstruction of the arguments used by the Milesian must remain conjectural. Verbatim reconstruction is of course impossible. Nevertheless, the data, provided they are handled with care, allow us to catch glimpses of what the arguments of Anaximander must have looked like. The important thing is, however, that he did not just utter apodictic statements, but also tried to give arguments. This is what makes him the first philosopher.

a. The Boundless has No Origin

Aristotle reports a curious argument, which probably goes back to Anaximander, in which it is argued that the Boundless has no origin, because it is itself the origin. We would say that it looks more like a string of associations and word-plays than like a formal argument. It runs as follows: “Everything has an origin or is an origin. The Boundless has no origin. For then it would have a limit. Moreover, it is both unborn and immortal, being a kind of origin. For that which has become has also, necessarily, an end, and there is a termination to every process of destruction” (Physics 203b6-10, DK 12A15). The Greeks were familiar with the idea of the immortal Homeric gods. Anaximander added two distinctive features to the concept of divinity: his Boundless is an impersonal something (or “nature,” the Greek word is “phusis”), and it is not only immortal but also unborn. However, perhaps not Anaximander, but Thales should be credited with this new idea. Diogenes Laërtius ascribes to Thales the aphorism: “What is the divine? That which has no origin and no end” (DK 11A1 (36)). Similar arguments, within different contexts, are used by Melissus (DK 30B2[9]) and Plato (Phaedrus 245d1-6).

b. The Origin Must be Boundless

Several sources give another argument which is somehow the other way round and answers the question of why the origin should be boundless. In Aristotle’s version, it runs like this: “(The belief that there is something Boundless stems from) the idea that only then genesis and decay will never stop, when that from which is taken what has been generated, is boundless” (Physics 203b18-20, DK 12A15, other versions in DK12A14 and 12A17). In this argument, the Boundless seems to be associated with an inexhaustible source. Obviously, it is taken for granted that “genesis and decay will never stop,” and the Boundless has to guarantee the ongoing of the process, like an ever-floating fountain.

c. The “Long Since” Argument

A third argument is relatively long and somewhat strange. It turns on one key word (in Greek: “êdê”), which is here translated with “long since.” It is reproduced by Aristotle: “Some make this (namely, that which is additional to the elements) the Boundless, but not air or water, lest the others should be destroyed by one of them, being boundless; for they are opposite to one another (the air, for instance, is cold, the water wet, and the fire hot). If any of them should be boundless, it would long since have destroyed the others; but now there is, they say, something other from which they are all generated” (Physics 204b25-29, DK 12A16).

This is not only virtually the same argument as used by Plato in his Phaedo (72a12-b5), but even more interesting is that it was used almost 2500 years later by Friedrich Nietzsche in his attempts to prove his thesis of the Eternal Recurrence: “If the world had a goal, it would have been reached. If there were for it some unintended final state, this also must have been reached. If it were at all capable of a pausing and becoming fixed, if it were capable of “being,” if in the whole course of its becoming it possessed even for a moment this capability of “being,” then again all becoming would long since have come to an end.” Nietzsche wrote these words in his notebook in 1885, but already in Die Philosophie im tragischen Zeitalter der Griechen (1873), which was not published during his lifetime, he mentioned the argument and credited Anaximander with it.

4. The Fragment

The only existing fragment of Anaximander’s book (DK 12B1) is surrounded by all kinds of questions. The ancient Greeks did not use quotation marks, so that we cannot be sure where Simplicius, who has handed down the text to us, is still paraphrasing Anaximander and where he begins to quote him. The text is cast in indirect speech, even the part which most authors agree is a real quotation. One important word of the text (“allêlois,” here translated by “upon one another”) is missing in some manuscripts. As regards the interpretation of the fragment, it is heavily disputed whether it means to refer to Anaximander’s principle, the Boundless, or not. The Greek original has relative pronouns in the plural (here rendered by “whence” and “thence”), which makes it difficult to relate them to the Boundless. However, Simplicius’ impression that it is written in rather poetic words has been repeated in several ways by many authors. Therefore, we offer a translation, in which some poetic features of the original, such as chiasmus and alliteration have been imitated:

Whence things have their origin,
Thence also their destruction happens,
As is the order of things;
For they execute the sentence upon one another
– The condemnation for the crime –
In conformity with the ordinance of Time.

In the fourth and fifth line a more fluent translation is given for what is usually rendered rather cryptic by something like “giving justice and reparation to one another for their injustice.”

We may distinguish roughly two lines of interpretation, which may be labeled the “horizontal” and the “vertical.” The horizontal interpretation holds that in the fragment nothing is said about the relation of the things to the Boundless, whereas the vertical interpretation maintains that the fragment describes the relationship of the things to the Boundless. The upholders of the horizontal interpretation usually do not deny that Anaximander taught that all things are generated from the Boundless, but they simply hold that this is not what is said in the fragment. They argue that the fragment describes the battle between the elements (or of things in general), which accounts for the origin and destruction of things. The most obvious difficulty, however, for this “horizontal” interpretation is that it implies two cycles of becoming and decay: one from and into the Boundless, and the other caused by the mutual give and take of the elements or things in general. In other words, in the “horizontal” interpretation the Boundless is superfluous. This is the strongest argument in favor of the “vertical” interpretation, which holds that the fragment refers to the Boundless, notwithstanding the plural relative pronouns. According to the “vertical” interpretation, then, the Boundless should be regarded not only as the ever-flowing fountain from which everything ultimately springs, but also as the yawning abyss (as some say, comparable with Hesiod’s “Chaos”) into which everything ultimately perishes.

The suggestion has been raised that Anaximander’s formula in the first two lines of the fragment should have been the model for Aristotle’s definition of the “principle” (Greek: “archê”) of all things in Metaphysics 983b8. There is some sense in this suggestion. For what could be more natural for Aristotle than to borrow his definition of the notion of “archê,” which he uses to indicate the principle of the first presocratic philosophers, from Anaximander, the one who introduced the notion?

It is certainly important that we possess one text from Anaximander’s book. On the other hand, we must recognize that we know hardly anything of its original context, as the rest of the book has been lost. We do not know from which part of his book it is, nor whether it is a text the author himself thought crucial or just a line that caught one reader’s attention as an example of Anaximander’s poetic writing style. The danger exists that we are tempted to use this stray text – beautiful and mysterious as it is – in order to produce all kinds of profound interpretations that are hard to verify. Perhaps a better way of understanding what Anaximander has to say is to study carefully the doxography, which goes back to people like Aristotle and Theophrastus, who probably have had Anaximander’s book before their eyes, and who tried to reformulate what they thought were its central claims.

5. The Origin of the Cosmos

The Boundless seems to have played a role in Anaximander’s account of the origin of the cosmos. Its eternal movement is said to have caused the origin of the heavens. Elsewhere, it is said that “all the heavens and the worlds within them” have sprung from “some boundless nature.” A part of this process is described in rather poetic language, full of images, which seems to be idiosyncratic for Anaximander: “a germ, pregnant with hot and cold, was separated [or: separated itself] off from the eternal, whereupon out of this germ a sphere of fire grew around the vapor that surrounds the earth, like a bark round a tree” (DK 12A10). Subsequently, the sphere of fire is said to have fallen apart into several rings, and this event was the origin of sun, moon, and stars. There are authors who have, quite anachronistically, seen here a kind of foreshadowing of the Kant-Laplace theory of the origin of the solar system. Some sources even mention innumerable worlds (in time and/or in space), which looks like a plausible consequence of the Boundless as principle. But this is presumably a later theory, incorrectly read back into Anaximander.

6. Astronomy

At first sight, the reports on Anaximander’s astronomy look rather bizarre and obscure. Some authors even think that they are so confused that we should give up trying to offer a satisfying and coherent interpretation. The only way of understanding Anaximander’s astronomical ideas, however, is to take them seriously and treat them as such, that is, as astronomical ideas. It will appear that many of the features of his universe that look strange at first sight make perfect sense on closer inspection.

a. Speculative Astronomy

The astronomy of neighboring peoples, such as the Babylonians and the Egyptians, consists mainly of observations of the rising and disappearance of celestial bodies and of their paths across the celestial vault. These observations were made with the naked eye and with the help of some simple instruments as the gnomon. The Babylonians, in particular, were rather advanced observers. Archeologists have found an abundance of cuneiform texts on astronomical observations. In contrast, there exists only one report of an observation made by Anaximander, which concerns the date on which the Pleiades set in the morning. This is no coincidence, for Anaximander’s merits do not lie in the field of observational astronomy, unlike the Babylonians and the Egyptians, but in that of speculative astronomy. We may discern three of his astronomical speculations: (1) that the celestial bodies make full circles and pass also beneath the earth, (2) that the earth floats free and unsupported in space, and (3) that the celestial bodies lie behind one another. Notwithstanding their rather primitive outlook, these three propositions, which make up the core of Anaximander’s astronomy, meant a tremendous jump forward and constitute the origin of our Western concept of the universe.

b. The Celestial Bodies Make Full Circles

The idea that the celestial bodies, in their daily course, make full circles and thus pass also beneath the earth – from Anaximander’s viewpoint – is so self-evident to us that it is hard to understand how daring its introduction was. That the celestial bodies make full circles is not something he could have observed, but a conclusion he must have drawn. We would say that this is a conclusion that lies to hand. We can see – at the northern hemisphere, like Anaximander – the stars around the Polar star making full circles, and we can also observe that the more southerly stars sometimes disappear behind the horizon. We may argue that the stars of which we see only arcs in reality also describe full circles, just like those near the Polar star. As regards the sun and moon, we can observe that the arcs they describe are sometimes bigger and sometimes smaller, and we are able to predict exactly where they will rise the next day. Therefore, it seems not too bold a conjecture to say that these celestial bodies also describe full circles. Nevertheless, it was a daring conclusion, precisely because it necessarily entailed the concept of the earth hanging free and unsupported in space.

c. The Earth Floats Unsupported in Space

Anaximander boldly asserts that the earth floats free in the center of the universe, unsupported by water, pillars, or whatever. This idea means a complete revolution in our understanding of the universe. Obviously, the earth hanging free in space is not something Anaximander could have observed. Apparently, he drew this bold conclusion from his assumption that the celestial bodies make full circles. More than 2500 years later astronauts really saw the unsupported earth floating in space and thus provided the ultimate confirmation of Anaximander’s conception. The shape of the earth, according to Anaximander, is cylindrical, like a column-drum, its diameter being three times its height. We live on top of it. Some scholars have wondered why Anaximander chose this strange shape. The strangeness disappears, however, when we realize that Anaximander thought that the earth was flat and circular, as suggested by the horizon. For one who thinks, as Anaximander did, that the earth floats unsupported in the center of the universe, the cylinder-shape lies at hand.

d. Why the Earth Does Not Fall

We may assume that Anaximander somehow had to defend his bold theory of the free-floating, unsupported earth against the obvious question of why the earth does not fall. Aristotle’s version of Anaximander’s argument runs like this: “But there are some who say that it (namely, the earth) stays where it is because of equality, such as among the ancients Anaximander. For that which is situated in the center and at equal distances from the extremes, has no inclination whatsoever to move up rather than down or sideways; and since it is impossible to move in opposite directions at the same time, it necessarily stays where it is.” (De caelo 295b10ff., DK 12A26) Many authors have pointed to the fact that this is the first known example of an argument that is based on the principle of sufficient reason (the principle that for everything which occurs there is a reason or explanation for why it occurs, and why this way rather than that).

Anaximander’s argument returns in a famous text in the Phaedo (108E4 ff.), where Plato, for the first time in history, tries to express the sphericity of the earth. Even more interesting is that the same argument, within a different context, returns with the great protagonist of the principle of sufficient reason, Leibniz. In his second letter to Clarke, he uses an example, which he ascribes to Archimedes but which reminds us strongly of Anaximander: “And therefore Archimedes (…) in his book De aequilibrio, was obliged to make use of a particular case of the great Principle of a sufficient reason. He takes it for granted that if there be a balance in which everything is alike on both sides, and if equal weights are hung on the two ends of that balance, the whole will stay at rest. This is because there is no reason why one side should weigh down, rather than the other”.

One may doubt, however, whether the argument is not fallacious. Aristotle already thought the argument to be deceiving. He ridicules it by saying that according to the same kind of argument a hair, which was subject to an even pulling power from opposing sides, would not break, and that a man, being just as hungry as thirsty, placed in between food and drink, must necessarily remain where he is and starve. To him it was the wrong argument for the right proposition. Absolute propositions concerning the non-existence of things are always in danger of becoming falsified on closer investigation. They contain a kind of subjective aspect: “as far as I know.” Several authors, however, have said that Anaximander’s argument is clear and ingenious. Already at first sight this qualification sounds strange, for the argument evidently must be wrong, as the earth is not in the center of the universe, although it certainly is not supported by anything but gravity. Nevertheless, we have to wait until Newton for a better answer to the question why the earth does not fall.

e. The Celestial Bodies Lie Behind One Another

When Anaximander looked at the heaven, he imagined, for the first time in history, space. Anaximander’s vision implied depth in the universe, that is, the idea that the celestial bodies lie behind one another. Although it sounds simple, this is a remarkable idea, because it cannot be based on direct observation. We do not see depth in the universe. The more natural and primitive idea is that of the celestial vault, a kind of dome or tent, onto which the celestial bodies are attached, all of them at the same distance, like in a planetarium. One meets this kind of conception in Homer, when he speaks of the brazen or iron heaven, which is apparently conceived of as something solid, being supported by Atlas, or by pillars.

f. The Order of the Celestial Bodies

Anaximander placed the celestial bodies in the wrong order. He thought that the stars were nearest to the earth, then followed the moon, and the sun farthest away. Some authors have wondered why Anaximander made the stars the nearest celestial bodies, for he should have noticed the occurrence of star-occultations by the moon. This is a typical anachronism, which shows that it not easy to look at the phenomena with Anaximander’s eyes. Nowadays, we know that the stars are behind the moon, and thus we speak of star-occultation when we see a star disappear behind the moon. But Anaximander had no reason at all, from his point of view, to speak of a star-occultation when he saw a star disappear when the moon was at the same place. So it is a petitio principii to say that for him occultations of stars were easy to observe. Perhaps he observed stars disappearing and appearing again, but he did not observe – could not see it as – the occultation of the star, for that interpretation did not fit his paradigm. The easiest way to understand his way of looking at it – if he observed the phenomenon at all – is that he must have thought that the brighter light of the moon outshines the much smaller light of the star for a while. Anaximander’s order of the celestial bodies is clearly that of increasing brightness. Unfortunately, the sources do not give further information of his considerations at this point.

g. The Celestial Bodies as Wheels

A peculiar feature of Anaximander’s astronomy is that the celestial bodies are said to be like chariot wheels (the Greek words for this image are presumably his own). The rims of these wheels are of opaque vapor, they are hollow, and filled with fire. This fire shines through at openings in the wheels, and this is what we see as the sun, the moon, or the stars. Sometimes, the opening of the sun wheel closes: then we observe an eclipse. The opening of the moon wheel regularly closes and opens again, which accounts for the phases of the moon. This image of the celestial bodies as huge wheels seems strange at first sight, but there is a good reason for it. There is no doxographic evidence of it, but it is quite certain that the question of why the celestial bodies do not fall upon the earth must have been as serious a problem to Anaximander as the question of why the earth does not fall. The explanation of the celestial bodies as wheels, then, provides an answer to both questions. The celestial bodies have no reason whatsoever to move otherwise than in circles around the earth, as each point on them is always as far from the earth as any other. It is because of reasons like this that for ages to come, when Anaximander’s concept of the universe had been replaced by a spherical one, the celestial bodies were thought of as somehow attached to crystalline or ethereal sphere-shells, and not as free-floating bodies.

Many authors, following Diels, make the image of the celestial wheels more difficult than is necessary. They say that the light of a celestial bodies shines through the openings of its wheel “as through the nozzle of a bellows.” This is an incorrect translation of an expression that probably goes back to Anaximander himself. The image of a bellows, somehow connected to a celestial wheel, tends to complicate rather than elucidate the meaning of the text. If we were to understand that every celestial body had such a bellows, the result would be hundreds of nozzles (or pipes), extending from the celestial wheels towards the earth. Anaximander’s intention, however, can be better understood not as an image, but as a comparison of the light of the celestial bodies with that of lightning. Lightning, according to Anaximander, is a momentary flash of light against a dark cloud. The light of a celestial body is like a permanent beam of lightning fire that originates from the opaque cloudy substance of the celestial wheel.

h. The Distances of the Celestial Bodies

The doxography gives us some figures about the dimensions of Anaximander’s universe: the sun wheel is 27 or 28 times the earth, and the moon wheel is 19 times the earth. More than a century ago, two great scholars, Paul Tannery and Hermann Diels, solved the problem of Anaximander’s numbers. They suggested that the celestial wheels were one unit thick, this unit being the diameter of the earth. The full series, they argued, had to be: 9 and 10 for the stars, 18 and 19 for the moon, and 27 and 28 for the sun. These numbers are best understood as indicating the distances of the celestial bodies to the earth. In others words, they indicate the radii of concentric circles, made by the celestial wheels, with the earth as the center. See Figure 1, a plane view of Anaximander’s universe.

These numbers cannot be based on observation. In order to understand their meaning, we have to look at Hesiod’s Theogony 722-725, where it is said that a brazen anvil would take nine days to fall from heaven to earth before it arrives on the tenth day. It is not a bold guess to suppose that Anaximander knew this text. The agreement with his numbers is too close to neglect, for the numbers 9 and 10 are exactly those extrapolated for Anaximander’s star wheel. Hesiod can be seen as a forerunner to Anaximander, for he tried to imagine the distance to the heaven. In the Greek counting system Hesiod’s numbers should be taken to mean “a very long time.” Thus, Troy was conquered in the tenth year after having stood the siege for nine years; and Odysseus scoured the seas for nine years before reaching his homeland in the tenth year. We may infer that Anaximander, with his number 9 (1 x 3 x 3) for the star ring, simply was trying to say that the stars are very far away. Now the numbers 18 and 27 can easily be interpreted as “farther” (2 x 3 x 3, for the moon ring) and “farthest” (3 x 3 x 3, for the sun ring). And this is exactly what we should expect one to say, who had discovered that the image of the celestial vault was wrong but that the celestial bodies were behind one another, and who wished to share this new knowledge with his fellow citizens in a language they were able to understand.

i. A Representation of Anaximander’s Universe

Although it is not attested in the doxography, we may assume that Anaximander himself drew a map of the universe, like that in figure 1. The numbers, 9, 10, 18, etc., can easily be understood as instructions for making such a map. Although Diogenes Laërtius reports that he made a “sphere,” the drawing or construction of a three-dimensional model must be considered to have been beyond Anaximander’s abilities. On the other hand, it is quite easy to explain the movements of the celestial bodies with the help of a plan view, by making broad gestures, describing circles in the air, and indicating direction, speed, and inclination with your hands, as is said of a quarrel between Anaxagoras and Oenopides (DK 41A2).

Almost nothing of Anaximander’s opinions about the stars has been handed down to us. Probably the best way to imagine them is as a conglomerate of several wheels, each of which has one or more holes, through which the inner fire shines, which we see as stars. The most likely sum-total of these star wheels is a sphere. The only movement of these star wheels is a rotation around the earth from east to west, always at the same speed, and always at the same place relative to one another in the heaven. The sun wheel shows the same rotation from east to west as the stars, but there are two differences. The first is that the speed of the rotation of the sun wheel is not the same as that of the stars. We can see this phenomenon by observing how the sun lags behind by approximately one degree per day. The second difference is that the sun wheel as a whole changes its position in the heaven. In summer it moves towards the north along the axis of the heaven and we see a large part of it above the horizon, whereas in winter we only observe a small part of the sun wheel, as it moves towards the south. This movement of the sun wheel accounts for the seasons. The same holds mutatis mutandis for the moon. Today, we use to describe this movement of the sun (and mutatis mutandis of the moon and the planets) as a retrograde movement, from west to east, which is a counter-movement to the daily rotation from east to west. In terms of Anaximander’s ancient astronomy it is more appropriate and less anachronistic to describe it as a slower movement of the sun wheel from east to west. The result is that we see different stars in different seasons, until the sun, at the end of a year, reaches its old position between the stars.

Due to the inclination of the axis of the heaven, the celestial bodies do not circle around the earth in the same plane as the earth’s – flat – surface, but are tilted. This inclination amounts to about 38.5 degrees when measured at Delphi, the world’s navel. The earth being flat, the inclination must be the same all over its surface. This tilting of the heaven’s axis must have been one of the biggest riddles of the universe. Why is it tilted at all? Who or what is responsible for this phenomenon? And why is it tilted just the way it is? Unfortunately, the doxography on Anaximander has nothing to tell us about this problem. Later, other Presocratics like Empedocles, Diogenes of Apollonia, and Anaxagoras discuss the tilting of the heavens.

Although there exists a report that says the contrary, it is not likely that Anaximander was acquainted with the obliquity of the ecliptic, which is the yearly path of the sun along the stars. The ecliptic is a concept which belongs to the doctrine of a spherical earth within a spherical universe. A three-dimensional representation of Anaximander’s universe is given in Figures 2 and 3.

7. Map of the World

Anaximander is said to have made the first map of the world. Although this map has been lost, we can imagine what it must have looked like, because Herodotus, who has seen such old maps, describes them. Anaximander’s map must have been circular, like the top of his drum-shaped earth. The river Ocean surrounded it. The Mediterranean Sea was in the middle of the map, which was divided into two halves by a line that ran through Delphi, the world’s navel. The northern half was called “Europe,” the southern half “Asia.” The habitable world (Greek: “oikoumenê”) consisted of two relatively small strips of land to the north and south of the Mediterranean Sea (containing Spain, Italy, Greece, and Asia Minor on the one side, and Egypt and Libya on the other side), together with the lands to the east of the Mediterranean Sea: Palestine, Assyria, Persia, and Arabia. The lands to the north of this small “habitable world” were the cold countries where mythical people lived. The lands to the south of it were the hot countries of the black burnt people.

8. Biology

The doxography tells us that according to Anaximander life originated from the moisture that covered the earth before it was dried up by the sun. The first animals were a kind of fish, with a thorny skin (the Greek word is the same that was used for the metaphor “the bark of a tree” in Anaximander’s cosmology). Originally, men were generated from fishes and were fed in the manner of a viviparous shark. The reason for this is said to be that the human child needs long protection in order to survive. Some authors have, rather anachronistically, seen in these scattered statements a proto-evolutionist theory.

9. Conclusion

It is no use trying to unify the information on Anaximander into one all-compassing and consistent whole. His work will always remain truncated, like the mutilated and decapitated statue that has been found at the market-place of Miletus and that bears his name. Nevertheless, by what we know of him, we may say that he was one of the greatest minds that ever lived. By speculating and arguing about the “Boundless” he was the first metaphysician. By drawing a map of the world he was the first geographer. But above all, by boldly speculating about the universe he broke with the ancient image of the celestial vault and became the discoverer of the Western world-picture.

10. References and Further Reading

• Diels, H. and W. Kranz, Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Zürich/Hildesheim 1964
  • The standard collection of the texts of and the doxography on Anaximander and the other presocratics.
• Guthrie, W.K.C. A History of Greek Philosophy I, The Earlier Presocratics and the Pythagoreans. London/New York 1985 (Cambridge 1962)
• Kirk, G.S., J.E. Raven, and M. Schofield, The Presocratic Philosophers, Cambridge 1995 (1957)
  • The above two works each have a good survey of Anaximander’s thoughts in the context of ancient Greek philosophy, with translations of the most important doxography.
• Kahn, C.H. Anaximander and the Origins of Greek Cosmology. New York 1960 (Indianapolis/Cambridge 1994)
  • A classical study on Anaximander’s cosmology and his fragment, also with many translations.
• Furley, D.J. and R.E. Allen, eds. Studies in Presocratic Philosophy, Vol. I, The Beginnings of Philosophy. New York/London 1970
  • Contains many interesting articles on Anaximander by different authors.
• Couprie, D.L., R. Hahn, and G. Naddaf, Anaximander in Context. Albany 2003
  • A volume with three recent studies on Anaximander.
• Kahn, C.H. “Anaximander and the Arguments Concerning the Apeiron at Physics 203b4-1.” in: Festschrift E. Kapp, Hamburg 1958, pp.19-29.
• Stokes, M.C. “Anaximander’s Argument.” in: R.A. Shiner & J. King-Farlow, eds., New Essays on Plato and the Presocratics. 1976, pp.1-22.
  • Two articles on some of Anaximander’s arguments.
• Dicks, D.R. “Solstices, Equinoxes, and the Presocratics,” The Journal of Hellenic Studies 86. 1966, pp.26-40
• Kahn, C.H. “On Early Greek Astronomy.” The Journal of Hellenic Studies 90. 1970, pp.99-116
  • Two conflicting articles on Anaximander’s astronomy.
• Furley, D.J. The Greek Cosmologists, Volume I, Cambridge 1987
• Dicks, D.R. Early Greek Astronomy to Aristotle . Ithaca/New York 1970
  • Two good books on early Greek astronomy.
• Bodnár, I.M. “Anaximander’s Rings,” Classical Quarterly 38. 1988, pp. 49-51
• O’Brien, D. “Anaximander’s Measurements,” The Classical Quarterly 17. 1967, pp.423-432
  • Two articles on important details of Anaximander’s astronomy.
• McKirahan, R. “Anaximander’s Infinite Worlds,” in A. Preus, ed., Essays in Ancient Greek Philosophy VI: Before Plato, Albany 2001, pp. 49-65
  • A recent article on ‘innumerable worlds.’
• Heidel, W.A. The Frame of the Ancient Greek Maps. With a Discussion of the Discovery of the Sphericity of the Earth. New York 1937
  • An old but still valuable book on Anaximander’s map of the world.
• Loenen, J.H.M.M. “Was Anaximander an Evolutionist?” Mnemosyme 4. 1954, pp.215-232
  • A discussion of Anaximander’s biology.
• West, M.L. Early Greek Philosophy and the Orient. Oxford 1971
  • A discussion of possible Iranian influence on Anaximander.
• Conche, M. Anaximandre. Fragments et Témoignages. Paris 1991
  • The best book in French.
• Classen, C.J. Ansätze. Beiträge zum Verständnis der frühgriechischen Philosophie. Würzburg/Amsterdam 1986
  • The best book in German.

Author Information

Dirk L. Couprie
Email: dirkcouprie@dirkcouprie.nl
The Netherlands

Marcus Aurelius (121—180 C.E.)

The philosophy of the Roman Emperor Marcus Aurelius can be found in a collection of personal writings known as the Meditations. These reflect the influence of Stoicism and, in particular, the philosophy of Epictetus, the Stoic. The Meditations may be read as a series of practical philosophical exercises, following Epictetus’ three topics of study, designed to digest and put into practice philosophical theory. Central to these exercises is a concern with the analysis of one’s judgements and a desire to cultivate a “cosmic perspective.”

From a modern perspective Marcus Aurelius is certainly not in the first rank of ancient philosophers. He is no Plato or Aristotle, nor even a Sextus Empiricus or Alexander of Aphrodisias. To a certain extent this judgement is perfectly fair and reasonable. However, in order to assess the philosophical qualities that Marcus does have and that are displayed in the Meditations it is necessary to emphasize that in antiquity philosophy was not conceived merely as a matter of theoretical arguments. Such arguments existed and were important, but they were framed within a broader conception of philosophy as a way of life. The aim was not merely to gain a rational understanding of the world but to allow that rational understanding to inform the way in which one lived. If one keeps this understanding of ‘philosophy’ in mind, then one becomes able to appreciate the function and the philosophical value of Marcus’ Meditations.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. The Meditations
3. Philosophy
   1. Stoicism
   2. The Influence of Epictetus
   3. The Three topoi
   4. Philosophical Exercises
   5. The Point of View of the Cosmos
4. Concluding Remarks
5. References and Further Reading
   1. Selected Editions and Translations of the Meditations
   2. Selected Studies

1. Life

Marcus Aurelius was born in 121 C.E.. His early education was overseen by the Emperor Hadrian, and he was later adopted by the Emperor Antoninus Pius in 138 C.E.. After an initial education in rhetoric undertaken by Fronto, Marcus later abandoned it in favor of philosophy. Marcus became Emperor himself in C.E. 161, initially alongside Lucius Verus, becoming sole Emperor in C.E. 169. Continual attacks meant that much of his reign was spent on campaign, especially in central Europe. However, he did find time to establish four Chairs of Philosophy in Athens, one for each of the principal philosophical traditions (Platonic, Aristotelian, Stoic, and Epicurean). He died in C.E. 180.

2. The Meditations

Marcus’ reputation as a philosopher rests upon one work, the Meditations. The Meditations take the form of a personal notebook and were probably written while Marcus was on campaign in central Europe, c. C.E. 171-175. The entries appear to be in no particular order and may simply be in the original order of composition. The repetition of themes and the occasional groups of quotations from other authors (see, for example, Med. 4.46, 11.33-39) add to this impression. Book One, however, is somewhat different from the rest of the text and may well have been written separately (a plan for it may be discerned in Med. 6.48).

The first recorded mention of the Meditations is by Themistius in C.E. 364. The current Greek title—ta eis heauton (‘to himself’)—derives from a manuscript now lost and may be a later addition (it is first recorded c. 900 by Arethas). The modern text derives primarily from two sources: a manuscript now in the Vatican and a lost manuscript (mentioned above), upon which the first printed edition (1558) was based.

Beyond the Meditations there also survives part of a correspondence between Marcus and his rhetoric teacher Fronto, probably dating from earlier in Marcus’ life (c. C.E. 138-166), discovered as a palimpsest in 1815. However, although this interesting discovery sheds some light on Marcus as an individual, it adds little to our understanding of his philosophy.

3. Philosophy

a. Stoicism

According to tradition, Marcus was a Stoic. His ancient biographer, Julius Capitolinus, describes him as such. Marcus also makes reference to a number of Stoics by whom he was taught and, in particular, mentions Rusticus from whom he borrowed a copy of the works of the Stoic philosopher Epictetus (Med. 1.7). However, nowhere in the Meditations does Marcus explicitly call himself a Stoic. This may simply reflect the likelihood that Marcus was writing only for himself rather than attempting to define himself to an audience. Yet it is probably fair to admit that Marcus was at least open to ideas from other philosophical traditions, being impressed by Stoic philosophy, but not merely an unthinking disciple of Stoicism.

b. The Influence of Epictetus

As has been noted, Marcus was clearly familiar with the Discourses of Epictetus, quoting them a number of times (see Med. 11.33-38). Epictetus’ fame in the second century is noted by a number of ancient sources, being hailed as the greatest of the Stoics (Aulus Gellius 1.2.6) and more popular than Plato (Origen Contra Celsus 6.2). If Marcus felt drawn towards Stoicism, then Epictetus would surely have stood out as the most important Stoic of the time. It is perhaps reasonable, then, to turn to Epictetus in order to explore the philosophical background to the Meditations.

c. The Three topoi

Central to Epictetus’ philosophy is his account of three topoi, or areas of study. He suggests that the apprentice philosopher should be trained in three distinct areas or topoi (see Epictetus Discourses 3.2.1-2):

1. Desires (orexeis) and aversions (ekkliseis);
2. Impulse to act (hormas) and not to act (aphormas);
3. Freedom from deception, hasty judgement, and anything else related to assents (sunkatatheseis).

These three areas of training correspond to the three types of philosophical discourse referred to by earlier Stoics; the physical, the ethical, and the logical (see Diogenes Laertius 7.39). For Epictetus, it is not enough merely to discourse about philosophy. The student of philosophy should also engage in practical training designed to digest philosophical principals, transforming them into actions. Only this will enable the apprentice philosopher to transform himself into the Stoic ideal of a wise person or sage (sophos). It is to this end that the three topoi are directed.

The first topos, concerning desire (orexis), is devoted to physics. It is not enough for the philosopher to know how Nature works; he must train his desires in the light of that knowledge so that he only desires what is in harmony with Nature. For the Stoic, Nature is a complex inter-connected physical system, identified with God, of which the individual is but one part. What might be called the practical implication of this conception of Nature is that an individual will inevitably become frustrated and unhappy if they desire things without taking into account the operations of this larger physical system. Thus, in order to become a Stoic sage—happy and in harmony with Nature—one must train one’s desires in the light of a study of Stoic physical theory.

The second topos, concerning impulse (hormê), is devoted to ethics. The study of ethical theory is of course valuable in its own right, but, for the Stoic who is training to be a sage, these theories must be translated into ethical actions. In order to transform the way in which one behaves, it is necessary to train the impulses that shape one’s behavior. By so doing the apprentice philosopher will be able not merely to say how a sage should act but also to act as a sage should act.

The third topos, concerning assent (sunkatathesis), is devoted to logic. It is important to remember here that for the Stoics the term ‘logic’ included not only dialectic but also much of what one would today call epistemology. According to Epictetus every impression (phantasia) that an individual receives often includes a value-judgement (hupolêpsis) made by the individual. When an individual accepts or gives assent (sunkatathesis) to an impression, assent is often given to the value-judgement as well. For instance, when one sees someone drink a lot of wine, one often judges that they are drinking too much wine (see, for example. Epictetus Handbook 45). Epictetus suggests that, in the light of Stoic epistemological theory, the apprentice philosopher should train himself to analyze his impressions carefully and be on guard not to give assent to unwarranted value-judgements.

For Epictetus, then, the student of philosophy must not only study the three types of philosophical discourse but also engage in these three types of philosophical training or exercise in order to translate that theory into actions. Marcus may himself be seen as a student of Epictetus, and so some scholars have suggested that the three topoi form a key to understanding the Meditations. Indeed, the Meditations may be approached as an example of a form of personal writing in which the very act of writing constituted a philosophical exercise designed to digest the three types of philosophical theory. In other words, the Meditations are a text produced by someone engaged in the three topoi outlined by Epictetus. This is hinted at in Med. 9.7 where Marcus exhorts himself to ‘wipe out impression (phantasia), check impulse (hormê), and quench desire (orexis)’.

d. Philosophical Exercises

The Meditations certainly do not present philosophical theories similar to those that one can find in, say, the surviving works of Aristotle. Nor are they comparable to a theoretical treatise like the Elements of Ethics by the Stoic Hierocles, possibly a contemporary of Marcus. Nevertheless, the Meditations remain essentially a philosophical text. As has already been noted, the Meditations are a personal notebook, written by Marcus to himself and for his own use. They do not form a theoretical treatise designed to argue for a particular doctrine or conclusion; their function is different. In order to understand this function it is necessary to introduce the idea of a philosophical exercise (askêsis).

In the Meditations Marcus engages in a series of philosophical exercises designed to digest philosophical theories, to transform his character or ‘dye his soul’ in the light of those theories (see, for example, Med. 5.16), and so to transform his behavior and his entire way of life. By reflecting upon philosophical ideas and, perhaps more importantly, writing them down, Marcus engages in a repetitive process designed to habituate his mind into a new way of thinking. This procedure is quite distinct from the construction of philosophical arguments and has a quite different function. Whereas the former is concerned with creating a particular philosophical doctrine, the latter is a practical exercise or training designed to assimilate that doctrine into one’s habitual modes of behavior. Following the account of three types of philosophical training outlined by Epictetus, Marcus reflects in the Meditations upon a medley of physical, ethical, and logical ideas. These written reflections constitute a second stage of philosophical education necessary after one has studied the philosophical theories (see, for example, Epictetus Discourses 1.26.3). By engaging in such written philosophical exercises Marcus attempts to transform his soul or inner disposition that will, in turn, alter his behavior. Thus, this second stage of philosophical education is the process by which a philosophical apprentice trains himself to put theories into practice, and so make progress towards wisdom.

e. The Point of View of the Cosmos

Of all the philosophical exercises in the Meditations the most prominent centers around what might be called ‘the point of view of the cosmos’. In a number of passages Marcus exhorts himself to overcome the limited perspective of the individual and experience the world from a cosmic perspective. For example:

You have the power to strip away many superfluous troubles located wholly in your judgement, and to possess a large room for yourself embracing in thought the whole cosmos, to consider everlasting time, to think of the rapid change in the parts of each thing, of how short it is from birth until dissolution, and how the void before birth and that after dissolution are equally infinite. (Med. 9.32; see also 2.17, 5.23, 7.47, 12.32)

In passages such as this Marcus makes implicit reference to a number of Stoic theories. Here, for instance, the Stoic physics of flux inherited from Heraclitus is evoked. Perhaps more important though is the reference to one’s judgement and the claim that this is the source of human unhappiness. Following Epictetus, Marcus claims that all attributions of good or evil are the product of human judgements. As Epictetus put it, what upsets people are not things themselves but rather their judgements about things (see Handbook 5). According to Epictetus’ epistemological theory (to the extent that it can be reconstructed) the impressions that an individual receives and that appear to reflect the nature of things are in fact already composite. They involve not only a perception of some external object but also an almost involuntary and unconscious judgement about that perception. This judgement will be a product of one’s preconceptions and mental habits. It is this composite impression to which an individual grants or denies assent, creating a belief. The task for the philosopher is to subject one’s impressions to rigorous examination, making sure that one does not give assent to (that is, accept as true) impressions that include any unwarranted value judgements.

Marcus’ personal reflections in the Meditations may be read as a series of written exercises aimed at analyzing his own impressions and rejecting his own unwarranted value judgements. For instance, he reminds himself:

Do not say more to yourself than the first impressions report. […] Abide always by the first impressions and add nothing of your own from within. (Med. 8.49)

These ‘first impressions’ are impressions before a value judgement has been made. For Marcus, human well-being or happiness (eudaimonia) is entirely dependent upon correctly examining one’s impressions and judgements. For once one has overcome false value-judgements—for instance that wealth and social standing are valuable and that one should compete for them against others—one will experience the cosmos as a single living being (identified with God) rather than a site of conflict and destruction. As Cicero put it in his summary of Stoic physics:

The various limited modes of being may encounter many external obstacles to hinder their perfect realization, but there can be nothing that can frustrate Nature as a whole, since she embraces and contains within herself all modes of being. (On the Nature of the Gods 2.35)

It is to this end—cultivating an experience of the cosmos as a unified living being identified with God—that the philosophical exercises in the Meditations are directed.

4. Concluding Remarks

From a modern perspective Marcus Aurelius is certainly not in the first rank of ancient philosophers. He is no Plato or Aristotle, nor even a Sextus Empiricus or Alexander of Aphrodisias. To a certain extent this judgement is perfectly fair and reasonable. However, in order to assess the philosophical qualities that Marcus does have and that are displayed in the Meditations it is necessary to emphasize that in antiquity philosophy was not conceived merely as a matter of theoretical arguments. Such arguments existed and were important, but they were framed within a broader conception of philosophy as a way of life. The aim was not merely to gain a rational understanding of the world but to allow that rational understanding to inform the way in which one lived. If one keeps this understanding of ‘philosophy’ in mind, then one becomes able to appreciate the function and the philosophical value of Marcus’ Meditations.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Selected Editions and Translations of the Meditations

• CROSSLEY, H., The Fourth Book of the Meditations of Marcus Aurelius Antoninus, A Revised Text with Translation and Commentary (London: Macmillan, 1882) – an excellent commentary, sadly of only one book.
• DALFEN, J., Marci Aurelii Antonini Ad Se Ipsum Libri XII, Bibliotheca Scriptorum Graecorum et Romanorum Teubneriana (Leipzig: Teubner, 1979; 2nd edn 1987) – includes an invaluable word index.
• FARQUHARSON, A. S. L., The Meditations of the Emperor Marcus Antoninus, Edited with Translation and Commentary, 2 vols (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1944) – arguably the definitive edition and essential for any serious study of the Meditations.
• FARQUHARSON, A. S. L.,The Meditations of Marcus Aurelius Antoninus, With Introduction and Notes by R. B. Rutherford (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989) – an edition reprinting only the translation from Farquharson’s 1944 edition, but supplemented with a helpful introduction and a selection from the correspondence with Fronto.
• GATAKER, T., Marci Antonini Imperatoris de rebus suis, sive de eis qae ad se pertinere censebat, Libri XII (Cambridge: Thomas Buck, 1652) – a justly famous early edition of the Meditations containing a substantial commentary.
• HAINES, C. R., The Communings with Himself of Marcus Aurelius Antoninus, A Revised Text and a Translation into English, The Loeb Classical Library (London: Heinemann, 1916; later reprints by Harvard University Press) – probably the most readily available edition of the Greek text, with a facing English translation. Haines also prepared a two-volume edition of the correspondence with Fronto for the Loeb Classical Library.
• LEOPOLD, I. H., M. Antoninus Imperator Ad Se Ipsum, Scriptorum Classicorum Bibliotheca Oxoniensis (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1908) – the OCT edition, now out of print.
• THEILER, W., Kaiser Marc Aurel, Wege Zu Sich Selbst (Zürich: Artemis, 1951) – a widely praised edition of the Greek text, with a facing German translation.

b. Selected Studies

• AFRICA, T. W., ‘The Opium Addiction of Marcus Aurelius’, Journal of the History of Ideas 22 (1961), 97-102.
• ARNOLD, E. V., Roman Stoicism: Being Lectures on the History of the Stoic Philosophy with Special Reference to its Development within the Roman Empire (Cambridge, 1911; repr. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1958)
• ASMIS, E., ‘The Stoicism of Marcus Aurelius’, ANRW II 36.3 (1989), pp. 2228-2252.
• BIRLEY, A. R., Marcus Aurelius: A Biography (London: Batsford, 1966; new edn Routledge 2000)
• BRUNT, P. A., ‘Marcus Aurelius in his Meditations‘, Journal of Roman Studies 64 (1974), 1-20.
• CLARKE, M. L., The Roman Mind: Studies in the History of Thought from Cicero to Marcus Aurelius (London: Cohen & West, 1956)
• HADOT, P., ‘Une clé des Pensées de Marc Aurèle: les trois topoi philosophiques selon Épictète’, Les Études philosophiques 1 (1978), 65-83.
• HADOT, P., The Inner Citadel: The Meditations of Marcus Aurelius, trans. M. Chase (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1998); a translation of La Citadelle Intérieure (Paris, 1992)
• KRAYE, J., ‘Ethnicorum omnium sanctissimus: Marcus Aurelius and his Meditations from Xylander to Diderot’, in J. Kraye & M. W. F. Stones, eds, Humanism and Early Modern Philosophy (London: Routledge, 2000), pp. 107-134.
• LONG, A. A., ‘Epictetus, Marcus Aurelius’, in T. J. Luce, ed., Ancient Writers: Greece and Rome (New York: Scribner’s, 1982), pp. 985-1002.
• MORFORD, M., The Roman Philosophers: From the Time of Cato the Censor to the Death of Marcus Aurelius (London: Routledge, 2002)
• NEWMAN, R. J., ‘Cotidie meditare: Theory and Practice of the meditatio in Imperial Stoicism’, ANRW II 36.3 (1989), pp. 1473-1517.
• RIST, J. M., ‘Are You a Stoic? The Case of Marcus Aurelius’, in B. F. Meyers & E. P. Sanders, eds, Jewish and Christian Self-Definition 3 (London: SCM, 1982), pp. 23-45.
• RUTHERFORD, R. B., The Meditations of Marcus Aurelius: A Study (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1989)
• STANTON, G. R., ‘The Cosmopolitan Ideas of Epictetus and Marcus Aurelius’, Phronesis 13 (1968), 183-195.
• WICKHAM LEGG, J., ‘A Bibliography of the Thoughts of Marcus Aurelius Antoninus’, Transactions of the Bibliographical Society 10 (1908-09, but publ. 1910), 15-81.

This article was written in 2002. Since then a number of new translations of the Meditations have been published, including ones by Robin Hard (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2011), Martin Hammond (London: Penguin, 2006), and Gregory Hays (London: Weidenfeld & Nicolson, 2003). Also, a number of new studies have also been published. The most important are Angelo Giavatto’s Interlocutore di se stesso: La dialettica di Marco Aurelio (Hildesheim: Georg Olms, 2008), Marcel van Ackeren’s Die Philosophie Marc Aurels, 2 vols (berlin: De Gruyter, 2011), and the chapters by many authors in Marcel van Ackeren, ed., A Companion to Marcus Aurelius (Chichester: Wiley-Blackwell, 2012). For an annotated and up-to-date guide to the literature on Marcus Aurelius see John Sellars, ‘Marcus Aurelius’, in D. Pritchard, ed., Oxford Bibliographies in Philosophy (New York: Oxford University Press, 2015), DOI 10.1093/obo/9780195396577-0278 (subscription required).

Author Information

John Sellars
Email: john.sellars (at) kcl.ac.uk
King’s College London
United Kingdom

Origen of Alexandria (185—254 C.E.)

Origen of Alexandria, one of the greatest Christian theologians,  is famous for composing the seminal work of Christian Neoplatonism, his treatise On First Principles. Origen lived through a turbulent period of the Christian Church, when persecution was wide-spread and little or no doctrinal consensus existed among the various regional churches. In this environment, Gnosticism flourished, and Origen was the first truly philosophical thinker to turn his hand not only to a refutation of Gnosticism, but to offer an alternative Christian system that was more rigorous and philosophically respectable than the mythological speculations of the various Gnostic sects. Origen was also an astute critic of the pagan philosophy of his era, yet he also learned much from it, and adapted its most useful and edifying teachings to a grand elucidation of the Christian faith. Porphyry (the illustrious student of Plotinus), though a tenacious adversary of Christianity, nevertheless grudgingly admitted Origen’s mastery of the Greek philosophical tradition. Although Origen did go on to compose numerous biblical commentaries and sermons, his importance for the history of philosophy rests mainly on two works, the systematic treatise On First Principles, and his response to the pagan philosopher Celsus’ attack on Christianity, the treatise Against Celsus. Since the purpose of this article is to introduce students and interested laypersons to the philosophy of Origen, it will be necessary to focus mainly on the treatise On First Principles, which is the most systematic and philosophical of Origen’s numerous writings. In this work Origen establishes his main doctrines, including that of the Holy Trinity (based upon standard Middle Platonic triadic emanation schemas); the pre-existence and fall of souls; multiple ages and transmigration of souls; and the eventual restoration of all souls to a state of dynamic perfection in proximity to the godhead. He is unique among Platonists of his era for introducing history into his cosmological and metaphysical speculations, and his insistence on the absolute freedom of each and every soul, thereby denying the fatalism that so often found its way into the more esoteric teachings of the various philosophical and mystery schools of his day.

Table of Contents

1. Origen’s Life and Times
2. His Intellectual Heritage: Pagan, Jewish and Christian
3. The Philosophical System of Origen
   1. The Trinity
   2. Souls and their Fall
   3. Multiple Ages, Metempsychosis, and the Restoration of All
4. Important Themes in Origen’s Philosophy
   1. Free Will
   2. Education and History
   3. Eternal Motion of Souls
5. Origen’s Importance in the History of Philosophy
   1. Hellenistic Philosophy
   2. Christianity
6. Concluding Summary
7. References and Further Reading
   

1. Origen’s Life and Times

Origen was, according to Eusebius, “not quite seventeen” when Septimius Severus’ persecution of the Christians began “in the tenth year of [his] reign,” (Ecclesiastical History; tr. Williamson, p. 179) which gives the approximate date of Origen’s birth as 185/6 C.E. He died around the reign of Gallus, which places his death in 254/5 C.E. Origen lived during a turbulent period of the Roman Empire, when the barbarian invasions were sweeping across Europe, threatening the stability of the Roman Empire. His was also a time of periodic persecution against Christians, notably during the reigns of the Emperors Severus, Maximin, and Decius, so that Origen’s life began and ended with persecution.

His family was devoutly Christian, and likely highly educated; for his father, who died a martyr, made sure that Origen was schooled not only in biblical studies, but in Hellenistic education as well. Eusebius (Ecclesiastical History, tr. Williamson, p. 182) tells us that Origen was only seventeen when he took over as Headmaster (didaskalos) of the Christian Catechetical School at Alexandria. He became interested in Greek philosophy quite early in his life, studying for a while under Ammonius Saccas (the teacher of Plotinus) and amassing a large collection of philosophical texts. It is probably around this time that he began composing On First Principles. However, as he became ever more devoted to the Christian faith, he sold his library, abandoning, for a time, any contact with pagan Greek wisdom, though he would eventually return to secular studies (Greek philosophy), from which he derived no small measure of inspiration, as Porphyry (recorded in Eusebius) makes quite clear, as he continued with his ever more sophisticated elucidation of biblical texts.

2. His Intellectual Heritage: Pagan, Jewish and Christian

Origen’s debt to Holy Scripture is obvious; he quotes the bible at great length, often drawing together seemingly disparate passages to make a profound theological point. Yet his thought is all the while informed by his Greek philosophical education, specifically that of the Middle Platonic tradition, notably the works of the Jewish Platonist Philo of Alexandria and the Neopythagorean philosopher Numenius of Apamea (fl. 150-176 C.E.). Origen shares with Philo an insistence on the free will of the person, a freedom that is direct evidence of humanity’s likeness to God – for, like God’s Being, human existence is free from all necessity. From Numenius, Origen likely adopted the conception of a “second god” proceeding from a first, ineffable being called the One, “First God,” or Father. Numenius referred to this “second god” as Demiurge or craftsman, and taught that he created the cosmos by imitating the intellectual content of the “First God.” Origen applied this basic notion to his doctrine of Christ, whom he also called Demiurge (Commentary on John 1.22), and went on to describe Christ as a reflection of the Truth of the Father, stating that compared to human beings Christ is Truth, but compared to the Father He is falsehood (Jerome, Epistle 92, quoting Origen; see also On First Principles 1.2.6).

Another extremely important part of Origen’s intellectual heritage is the concept of apokatastasis or “restoration of all things.” This term first appears, as a philosophical concept, in the writings of the Stoics, whose materialistic pantheism led them to identify Zeus with the pure, “craftsmanly” fire pervading and constituting the cosmos. According to the Stoics, this fire expands and contracts according to a fixed cycle. They called the contraction a “conflagration” (ekpurôsis), destroying the cosmos, yet only temporarily. This contraction was described as Zeus returning to his own thoughts, to contemplate the eternal perfection of his mind/cosmos (the material cosmos being the expression of his mind, or Logos). The expansion would occur when Zeus once again expressed his mind in the creation of the material cosmos; this re-creation or reconstitution of the cosmos is what the Stoics called apokatastasis. Some Stoics argued that since Zeus is perfect mind, then every reconstitution of the cosmos will resemble identically the one that preceded it. This Stoic doctrine was to have an immense influence on the development of the so-called esoteric traditions in the Hellenistic era, notably the Hermetic school, Gnosticism, and astrology, with all of which Origen was, in varying degrees, familiar.

In Origen’s time, Christianity as a religion had not yet developed a system of theology as a basis of orthodoxy; therefore, in addition to a wide variety of opinions regarding the faith, there were also various sects, each claiming to possess the truth of the Christian faith. Foremost among these sects was the group of schools loosely labelled ‘gnostic.’ The Valentinian school (founded by Valentinus, an outstanding teacher and philosopher who was at one point a candidate for bishop of Rome) was the most philosophically accomplished of the Christian Gnostic sects. In his Commentary on John, Origen refutes the doctrines of a Valentinian Gnostic named Heracleon, who had earlier written a commentary on the same Gospel. While Origen’s opposition to Gnosticism precluded any doctrinal influence, he saw in Gnosticism the value of a system, for it was precisely by virtue of their elaborate and self-consistent systems that the Gnostics were successful in gaining adherents. Since there were no non-Gnostic Christian theological systems in his day, it was up to Origen to formulate one. This was the program of his treatise On First Principles.

3. The Philosophical System of Origen

Origen was the first systematic theologian and philosopher of the Christian Church. Earlier Christian intellectuals had confined themselves to apologetic and moralizing works; notable among such writers is Clement of Alexandria (d. 215 C.E.), who, like Origen, found much of value in Hellenic philosophy. Before proceeding with an examination of Origen’s system, it must be noted that scholars are divided over the question of whether or not his On First Principles contains a system. Henri Crouzel (1989), for example, has argued that the presence of contradictory statements in certain portions of the treatise, as well as in other texts, is proof against the claim that Origen was presenting a system. Hans Jonas (1974), on the other hand, recognized a clear system in On First Principles and gave a convincing elucidation of such. The reason for this scholarly divide is mostly due to the lack of a precise definition of ‘system’ and ‘systematic’. If one approaches Origen’s text expecting a carefully worked-out system of philosophy in the manner of a Kant or a Hegel, one will be disappointed. However, if one reads the text with an eye for prominent themes and inner consistency of such themes with one another, a system does emerge. As John Dillon has pointed out, Origen succeeded in luring away several students of the renowned Platonic teacher Ammonius Saccas to study with him, and, Dillon convincingly observes, this would not have been possible if Origen did not have some system to offer (Dillon, in Kannengiesser, Petersen, ed. 1988, p. 216, and footnote). It must also be pointed out that the text of On First Principles that we possess is not complete. Origen’s original Greek is preserved only in fragments, the remainder of the text is extant only in a Latin translation by Rufinus, who was a defender of Origen against posthumous charges of heresy. While Rufinus’ translation is, as far as we can tell, faithful in most respects, there is ample evidence that he softened certain potentially troublesome passages in an ill-guided attempt to redeem his beloved teacher. When reading Origen’s treatise, then, one would do well to keep this in mind should one stumble across seemingly contradictory passages, for one has no way of knowing what the original Greek might have said.

a. The Trinity

Origen begins his treatise On First Principles by establishing, in typical Platonic fashion, a divine hierarchical triad; but instead of calling these principles by typical Platonic terms like monad, dyad, and world-soul, he calls them “Father,” “Christ,” and “Holy Spirit,” though he does describe these principles using Platonic language. The first of these principles, the Father, is a perfect unity, complete unto Himself, and without body – a purely spiritual mind. Since God the Father is, for Origen, “personal and active,” it follows that there existed with Him, always, an entity upon which to exercise His intellectual activity. This entity is Christ the Son, the Logos, or Wisdom (Sophia), of God, the first emanation of the Father, corresponding to Numenius’ “second god,” as we have seen above (section 2). The third and last principle of the divine triad is the Holy Spirit, who “proceeds from the Son and is related to Him as the Son is related to the Father” (A. Tripolitis 1978, p. 94). Here is Origen explaining the status of the Holy Spirit, in a passage preserved in the original Greek:

The God and Father, who holds the universe together, is superior to every being that exists, for he imparts to each one from his own existence that which each one is; the Son, being less than the Father, is superior to rational creatures alone (for he is second to the Father); the Holy Spirit is still less, and dwells within the saints alone. So that in this way the power of the Father is greater than that of the Son and of the Holy Spirit, and that of the Son is more than that of the Holy Spirit, and in turn the power of the Holy Spirit exceeds that of every other holy being (Fragment 9 [Koetschau] tr. Butterworth 1966, pp. 33-34, and footnote).

This graded hierarchy reveals an allotment of power to the second and third members of the Trinity: the Father’s power is universal, but the Son’s corresponds only to rational creatures, while the Spirit’s power corresponds strictly to the “saints” or those who have achieved salvation. Such a structure of divine influence on the created realm is found much later in the system of the Neoplatonic philosopher Proclus (see J. Dillon, in G. Vesey, ed. 1989).

b. Souls and their Fall

According to Origen, God’s first creation was a collectivity of rational beings which he calls logika. “Although Origen speaks of the logika as being created, they were not created in time. Creation with respect to them means that they had a beginning, but not a temporal one” (Tripolitis 1978, p. 94). Further, Origen explains that the number of these rational beings is necessarily limited, since an infinite creation would be incomprehensible, and unworthy of God. These souls were originally created in close proximity to God, with the intention that they should explore the divine mysteries in a state of endless contemplation. They grew weary of this intense contemplation, however, and lapsed, falling away from God and into an existence on their own terms, apart from the divine presence and the wisdom to be found there. This fall was not, it must be understood, the result of any inherent imperfection in the creatures of God, rather, it was the result of a misuse of the greatest gift of God to His creation: freedom. The only rational creature who escaped the fall and remained with God is the “soul of Christ” (Origen, On First Principles 2.6.5; Tripolitis 1978, p. 96). This individual soul is indicative of the intended function of all souls, i.e., to reveal the divine mystery in unique ways, insofar as the meaning of this mystery is deposited within them, as theandric (God-human) potentiality, to be drawn out and revealed through co-operation with God (On First Principles 2.9.2-8). As Origen explains, the soul of Christ was no different from that of any of the souls that fell away from God, for Christ’s soul possessed the same potential for communion with God as that of all other souls. What distinguished the soul of Christ from all others – and what preserved Him from falling away – was His supreme act of free choice, to remain immersed in the divinity.

What are now souls (psukhê) began as minds, and through boredom or distraction grew “cold” (psukhesthai) as they moved away from the “divine warmth” (On First Principles 2.8.3). Thus departing from God, they came to be clothed in bodies, at first of “a fine ethereal and invisible nature,” but later, as souls fell further away from God, their bodies changed “from a fine, ethereal and invisible body to a body of a coarser and more solid state. The purity and subtleness of the body with which a soul is enveloped depends upon the moral development and perfection of the soul to which it is joined. Origen states that there are varying degrees of subtleness even among the celestial and spiritual bodies” (Tripolitis 1978, p. 106). When a soul achieves salvation, according to Origen, it ceases being a soul, and returns to a state of pure “mind” or understanding. However, due to the fall, now “no rational spirit can ever exist without a body” (Tripolitis 1978, p. 114), but the bodies of redeemed souls are “spiritual bodies,” made of the purest fire (see A. Scott 1991, Chapter 9).

c. Multiple Ages, Metempsychosis, and the Restoration of All

Origen did not believe in the eternal suffering of sinners in hell. For him, all souls, including the devil himself, will eventually achieve salvation, even if it takes innumerable ages to do so; for Origen believed that God’s love is so powerful as to soften even the hardest heart, and that the human intellect – being the image of God – will never freely choose oblivion over proximity to God, the font of Wisdom Himself. Certain critics of Origen have claimed that this teaching undermines his otherwise firm insistence on free will, for, these critics argue, the souls must maintin the freedom to ultimately reject or accept God, or else free will becomes a mere illusion. What escapes these critics is the fact that Origen’s conception of free will is not our own; he considered freedom in the Platonic sense of the ability to choose the good. Since evil is not the polar opposite of good, but rather simply the absence of good – and thus having no real existence – then to ‘choose’ evil is not to make a conscious decision, but to act in ignorance of the measure of all rational decision, i.e., the good. Origen was unable to conceive of a God who would create souls that were capable of dissolving into the oblivion of evil (non-being) for all eternity. Therefore, he reasoned that a single lifetime is not enough for a soul to achieve salvation, for certain souls require more education or ‘healing’ than others. So he developed his doctrine of multiple ages, in which souls would be re-born, to experience the educative powers of God once again, with a view to ultimate salvation. This doctrine, of course, implies some form of transmigration of souls or metempsychosis. Yet Origen’s version of metempsychosis was not the same as that of the Pythagoreans, for example, who taught that the basest of souls will eventually become incarnated as animals. For Origen, some sort of continuity between the present body, and the body in the age to come, was maintained (Jerome, Epistle to Avitus 7, quoting Origen; see also Commentary on Matthew 11.17). Origen did not, like many of his contemporaries, degrade the body to the status of an unwanted encrustation imprisoning the soul; for him, the body is a necessary principle of limitation, providing each soul with a unique identity. This is an important point for an understanding of Origen’s epistemology, which is based upon the idea that God educates each soul according to its inherent abilities, and that the abilities of each soul will determine the manner of its knowledge. We may say, then, that the uniqueness of the soul’s body is an image of its uniqueness of mind. This is the first inkling of the development of the concept of the person and personality in the history of Western thought.

The restoration of all beings (apokatastasis) is the most important concept in Origen’s philosophy, and the touchstone by which he judges all other theories. His concept of universal restoration is based on equally strong Scriptural and Hellenistic philosophical grounds and is not original, as it can be traced back to Heraclitus, who stated that “the beginning and end are common” (Fragment B 103, tr. J. Barnes 1987, p. 115). Considering that Origen’s later opponents based their charges of heresy largely on this aspect of his teaching, it is surprising to see how well-grounded in scripture this doctrine really is. Origen’s main biblical proof-text is 1 Corinthians 15:25-28, especially verse 28, which speaks of the time “when all things shall be subdued unto him [Christ], then shall the Son also himself be subject unto him that put all things under him, that God may be all in all” (KJV, my emphasis). This scriptural notion of God being “all in all” (panta en pasin) is a strong theological support for his theory of apokatastasis. There are, of course, numerous other passages in scripture that contradict this notion, but we must remember that Origen’s strength resided in his philosophical ability to use reason and dialectic in support of humane doctrines, not in the ability to use scripture in support of dogmatical and anti-humanistic arguments. Origen imagined salvation not in terms of the saved rejoicing in heaven and the damned suffering in hell, but as a reunion of all souls with God.

4. Important Themes in Origen’s Philosophy

While Origen’s lengthy treatise On First Principles contains numerous discussions of a wide variety of issues relevant to the Christianity of his day, as well as to broader philosophical concerns, certain key themes do emerge that are of universal and timeless value for philosophy. These themes are: free will; the educational value of history; and the infinity and eternal motion (becoming) of human beings.

a. Free Will

Origen’s conception of freedom, as discussed above, was not the same as modern conceptions. This is not to say that his conception was wrong, of course. For Origen recognized freedom only in reason, in rationality, which is precisely the ability to recognize and embrace the good, which is for him God. Irrationality is ignorance, the absence of a conception of the good. The ignorant person cannot be held responsible for his ignorance, except to the extent that he has been lazy, not applying himself to the cultivation of reason. The moral dimension of this conception of freedom is that ignorance is not to be punished, but remedied through education. Punishment, understood in the punative sense, is of no avail and will even lead to deeper ignorance and sin, as the punished soul grows resentful, not understanding why he is being punished. Origen firmly believed that the knowledge of the good (God) is itself enough to remove all taint of sin and ignorance from souls. A ‘freedom’ to embrace evil (the absence of good) would have made no sense to Origen who, as a Platonist, identified evil with enslavement and goodness with freedom. The soul who has seen the good, he argued, will not fall into ignorance again, for the good is inspiring and worthy of eternal contemplation (see Commentary on Romans 5.10.15).

b. Education and History

Origen may rightfully be called the first philosopher of history, for, like Hegel, he understood history as a process involving the participation of persons in grand events leading to an eventual culmination or ‘end of history’. Unlike mainstream Christian eschatology, Origen did not understand the end of history as the final stage of a grand revelation of God, but rather as the culmination of a human-divine (co-operative) process, in which the image and likeness of God (humanity) is re-united with its source and model, God Himself (see Against Celsus 4.7; On First Principles 2.11.5, 2.11.7; Tripolitis 1978, p. 111). This is accomplished through education of souls who, having fallen away from God, are now sundered from the divine presence and require a gradual re-initiation into the mysteries of God. Such a reunion must not be accomplished by force, for God will never, Origen insists, undermine the free will of His creatures; rather, God will, over the course of numerous ages if need be, educate souls little by little, leading them eventually, by virtue of their own growing responsiveness, back to Himself, where they will glory in the uncovering of the infinite mysteries of the eternal godhead (On First Principles 2.11.6-7).

c. Eternal Motion of Souls

A common motif in Platonism during, before, and after Origen’s time is salvific stasis, or the idea that the soul will achieve complete rest and staticity when it finally ascends to a contemplation of the good. We notice this idea early on in Plato, who speaks in the Republic (517c-d, 519c-e) of a state of pure contemplation from which the philosopher is only wrenched by force or persuasion. In Origen’s own time, Plotinus developed his notion of an ‘about-face’ (epistrophê) of the soul resulting in an instant union of the soul with its divine principle, understood as an idealized, changeless form of contemplation, allowing for no dynamism or personal development (see Enneads 4.3.32, 4.8.4, for example). Influenced indirectly by Plotinus, and more directly by later Neoplatonists (both Christian and pagan), the Christian theologian St. Maximus the Confessor elaborated a systematic philosophical theology culminating in an eschatology in which the unique human person was replaced by the overwhelming, transcendent presence of God (see Chapters on Knowledge 2.88). Origen managed to maintain the transcendentality of God on the one hand, and the dynamic persistence of souls in being on the other. He did this by defining souls not by virtue of their intellectual content (or, in the Plotinian sense, for example, by virtue of their ‘prior’ or higher, constitutive principle) but rather by their ability to engage in a finite manner with the infinite God. This engagement is constitutive of the soul’s existence, and guarantees its uniqueness. Each soul engages uniquely with God in contemplating divine mysteries according to its innate ability, and this engagement persists for all eternity, for the mysteries of the godhead are inexhaustible, as is the enthusiastic application of the souls’ intellectual ability.

5. Origen’s Importance in the History of Philosophy

Throughout this article, Origen’s importance has largely been linked to his melding of philosophical insights with elucidations of various aspects of the Christian fatih. Yet his importance for Hellenistic philosophy is marked, and though not quite as pervasive as his influence on Christian thought, is nevertheless worth a few brief remarks. His role in the formation of Christian doctrine is more prominent, yet, because of its problematical nature, will be treated of only briefly.

a. Hellenistic Philosophy

Origen’s debt to Hellenistic (Greek) philosophy is quite obvious; his influence on the development of later pagan philosophy is – at least from the perspective of most contemporary scholarship – rather less obvious, but it is there. His trinitarian doctrine, for example, consisted of a gradation of influence beginning with the Father, whose influence was of the most general, universal kind, binding together all things; the influence of the Son extended strictly to sentient beings; the Holy Spirit’s influence extended only to the ‘elect’ or saints who had already achieved salvation (Dillon, in D.J. O’Meara, ed., 1982, p. 20; see also On First Principles 1.3.5). This conception found later expression in Proclus’ Elements of Theology (Proposition 57), where he elucidates this formulation: “Every cause both operates prior to its consequent and gives rise to a greater number of posterior terms” (tr. Dodds). For Origen, the pre-existent souls, through their fall, gave rise to a history over which both the Father and the Son came to preside, while the Holy Spirit only enters into human reality to effect a salvific re-orientation toward God that is already the result of an achieved history. The Holy Spirit, then, may be understood as the final cause, the preparatory causes of which are the Father and Son, the mutual begetters of history. A bit later, the pagan philosopher Iamblichus reversed this Origenian notion, claiming that the influence of the divine became stronger and more concentrated the further it penetrated into created reality, extending in its pure power even to stones and plants. In this sense, the Holy Spirit, limited as it is (according to Origen) to interaction with the saints alone, gives way to the universal power of the Father, which extends to the furthest reaches of reality. Iamblichus saw no reason to divide the divinity into persons or emanative effects; rather, he saw the divinity as operative, in varying degrees, at every level of reality. At the lowest level, however, this power is most effective, imparting power to plants and stones, and providing support for the theurgical practice advocated by Iamblichus (Olympiodorus, Commentary on Alcibiades I, 115A; Psellus, Chaldaean Expositions 1153a10-11; Dillon, ed. O’Meara 1982, p. 23).

b. Christianity

Origen’s ideas, most notably those in the treatise On First Principles, gave rise to a movement in the Christian Church known as Origenism. From the third through the sixth centuries this movement was quite influential, especially among the monastics, and was given articulate – if excessively codified form – by the theologian Evagrius Ponticus (c. 345-400 C.E.). It is to be noted that the spirit of philosophical inquiry exemplified by Origen was largely absent from the movement bearing his name. A far more creative use of Origen’s concepts and themes was made by Gregory of Nyssa (d. ca. 386 C.E.), who adopted Origen’s doctrine of apokatastasis or “restoration of all things.” Gregory was also responsible for articulating more clearly than did Origen the notion that redeemed souls will remain in a state of dynamic intellectual activity (see Gregory of Nyssa, Catechetical Oration, esp. Chapters 26 and 35). After the posthumous condemnation of Origen (and Origenism) in the fifth century, it became increasingly difficult for mainstream theologians to make use of his work. Pseudo-Dionysius the Areopagite (5th or 6th Century C.E.) drew upon Neoplatonic philosophy, especially Proclus (411-485 C.E.) and Iamblichus (ca. 240-325 C.E.), and though he followed in Origen’s footsteps in this use of pagan wisdom, he never mentioned his predecessor by name. In the seventh century, Maximus the Confessor (ca. 580-662), who may be called the last great Christian Neoplatonist, set about revising Origen’s doctrines in a manner more acceptable to the theological climate of the early Byzantine Church. Maximus changed the historicism of Origen into a more introspective, personal struggle to attain the divine vision through asceticism and prayer, the result being a total subsumption of the person by the godhead. This was Maximus’ vision of salvation: the replacement of the ego by the divine presence (see L. Thunberg 1985, p. 89; also Maximus, Chapters on Knowledge 2.88). While there is much that may be called brilliant and even inspiring in Maximus’ philosophical theology, this loss of the centrality of the person – as unique, unrepeatable entity – in the cosmic process of salvation led to the loss of a sense of co-operation of humanity and God, and sapped Christianity of the intellectual vigor that it displayed in the period leading up to the establishment of a theocratical Byzantine state.

Thankfully, Origen’s legacy was not lost. He was an inspiration to the Renaissance Humanists and, more recently, to certain Existentialist Christian theologians, notably Nicolas Berdyaev (1874-1948) whose insistence on the absolute autonomy and nobility of the person in the face of all objectifying reality is an echo across the ages of the humanism of Origen. Berdyaev himself admits Origen’s influence on his thought (as well as that of Gregory of Nyssa) and insists that the doctrine of hell and the eternal suffering of sinners is not compatible with authentic Christianity. He also places a great importance on history, and even broaches a modern, de-mythologized conception of metempsychosis in terms of a universal, shared history of which all persons are a part, regardless of their temporal specificity. History, according to Berdyaev (and in this he follows Origen) binds all of humanity together. No soul will be saved in isolation; all must be saved together, or not be saved at all. Berdyaev wrote numerous works, a few of the most important are Slavery and Freedom (Eng. tr. 1944), The Beginning and the End(Eng. tr.1952), and Truth and Revelation (Eng. tr. 1962).

6. Concluding Summary

Origen was an innovator in an era when innovation, for Christians, was a luxury ill-afforded. He drew upon pagan philosophy in an effort to elucidate the Christian faith in a manner acceptable to intellectuals, and he succeeded in converting many gifted pagan students of philosophy to his faith. He was also a great humanist, who believed that all creatures will eventually achieve salvation, including the devil himself. Origen did not embrace the dualism of Gnosticism, nor that of the more primitive expressions of the Christian faith still extant in his day. Rather, he took Christianity to a higher level, finding in it a key to the perfection of the intellect or mind, which is what all souls are in their pure form. The restoration of all souls to a purely intellectual existence was Origen’s faith, and his philosophy was based upon such a faith. In this, he is an heir to Socrates and Plato, but he also brought a new conception into philosophy – that of the creative aspect of the soul, as realized in history, the culmination of which is salvation, after which follows an eternal delving into the deep mysteries of God.

7. References and Further Reading

Bibliography

Selected Works by Origen in English Translation

• Origen, Against Celsus, tr. F. Crombie (The Ante-Nicene Fathers 4; Michigan: Eerdmans 1979, reprint).
• Origen, On First Principles, tr. G.W. Butterworth (New York: Harper and Row 1966).
• Origen, Commentary on John, tr. A. Menzies (The Ante-Nicene Fathers 10; Michigan: Eerdmans 1978, reprint).
• Origen, Commentary on Matthew, tr. J. Patrick (The Ante-Nicene Fathers 10; Michigan: Eerdmans 1978, reprint).
• Origen, Commentary on the Epistle to the Romans (Books 1-5), tr. T.P. Scheck (Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press 2001).
• Origen, Commentary on the Epistle to the Romans (Books 6-10), tr. T.P. Scheck (Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press 2002).

Other Sources

• Berdyaev, Nicholas, The Beginning and the End, tr. R.M. French (New York: Harper and Brothers 1952).
• Berdyaev, Nicholas, Slavery and Freedom, tr. R.M. French (New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons 1944).
• Berdyaev, Nicholas, Truth and Revelation, tr. R.M. French (New York: Collier Books 1962).
• Chadwick, H., Early Christian Thought and the Classical Tradition: Studies in Justin, Clement, and Origen (New York: Oxford University Press 1966).
• Crouzel, H., Origen: The Life and Thought of the First Great Theologian, tr. A.S. Worrall (T.&T. Clark Ltd. 1989).
• Dillon, J.M., The Middle Platonists(Ithaca: Cornell University Press 1977).
• Hardy, E.R., Christology of the Later Fathers (Philadelphia: The Westminster Press 1954).
• Jonas, H., “Origen’s Metaphysics of Free Will, Fall, and Salvation: A ‘Divine Comedy’ of the Universe,” in Philosophical Essays: From Ancient Creed to Technological Man (Englewood Cliffs, NJ: PrenticeHall 1974).
• Kannengiesser, C., Petersen, W.L., eds., Origen of Alexandria: His World and His Legacy (Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press 1988).
• Kelly, J.N.D., Early Christian Doctrines (New York: Harper and Row 1978).
• Louth, A., Maximus the Confessor (New York: Routledge 1996).
• Luibheid, C., Rorem, P., tr., Pseudo-Dionysius: The Complete Works (Mahwah, NJ: Paulist Press 1987).
• Meyendorff, J., Christ in Eastern Christian Thought (Crestwood: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press 1975).
• Murphy, F.X., “Evagrius Ponticus and Origenism,” in R. Hanson and H. Crouzel, ed., Origeniana Tertia (1981).
• O’Meara, D.J., ed., Neoplatonism and Christian Thought (New York: State University of New York Press 1982).
• Pelikan, J., Christianity and Classical Culture: The Metamorphosis of Natural Theology in the Christian Encounter with Hellenism (New Haven: Yale University Press 1993).
• Pelikan, J., The Christian Tradition: A History of the Development of Doctrine, vol. 2: “The Spirit of Eastern Christendom (600-1700) (Chicago: University of Chicago Press 1974).
• Scott, A., Origen and the Life of the Stars: A History of an Idea (Oxford: Clarendon Press 1991).
• Shaw, G., Theurgy and the Soul: The Neoplatonism of Iamblichus (University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press 1995).
• Siorvanes, L., Proclus: Neo-Platonic Philosophy and Science (New Haven: Yale University Press 1996).
• Stevenson, J., ed. A New Eusebius: Documents Illustrative of the History of the Church to A.D. 337 (London: S.P.C.K. 1957).
• Tatakis, B., Byzantine Philosophy, tr. N.J. Moutafakis (Indianapolis: Hackett 2003).
• Thunberg, L., Man and the Cosmos: The Vision of St. Maximus the Confessor (Crestwood, NY: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press 1985).
• Trigg, J.W., Origen: The Bible and Philosophy in the Third-century Church (Atlanta: John Knox Press 1983).
• Tripolitis, A., The Doctrine of the Soul in the Thought of Plotinus and Origen (New York: Libra 1978).
• Werner, M., The Formation of Christian Dogma, tr. S.G.F. Brandon ( Harper and Brothers 1957).
• Williamson, G.A., tr., Eusebius, The History of the Church (New York: Penguin Books 1965).
• Zeller, E., Outlines of the History of Greek Philosophy, tr. L.R. Palmer (New York: Meridian Books 1955).

Author Information

Edward Moore
Email: patristics@gmail.com
St. Elias School of Orthodox Theology
U. S. A.

Pseudo-Dionysius the Areopagite (fl. 500 C.E.)

Dionysius is the author of three long treatises (The Divine Names, The Celestial Hierarchy, and The Ecclesiastical Hierarchy) one short treatise (The Mystical Theology) and ten letters expounding various aspects of Christian Philosophy from a mystical and Neoplatonic perspective. Presenting himself as Dionysius the Areopagite, the disciple of Paul mentioned in Acts 17:34, his writings had the status of apostolic authority until the 19th century when studies had shown the writings denoted a marked influence from the Athenian Neoplatonic school of Proclus and thus were probably written ca. 500.  Although the attribution of authorship has proven to be a falsification, the unknown author (hereafter referred to as Ps-Dionysius) has not lost his credibility as an articulate Athenian Neoplatonist expressing an authentic Christian mystical tradition. Indeed with eloquent poetic language and strong exposition of ideas, the Dionysian corpus ranks among the classics of western spirituality.

Table of Contents

1. History and Development of Christian Platonism up to Pseudo-Dionysius
2. Mystery Schools, Gnosticism, Hermeticism, and the “Platonic Underground”
3. The Works of Dionysius the Areopagite
   1. The Divine Names (13 Chapters)
   2. The Mystical Theology (5 Chapters)
   3. The Celestial Hierarchy (15 Chapters)
   4. The Ecclesiastical Hierarchy (7 Chapters)
   5. The Epistles (10 Letters)
4. The Dionysian Influence
   1. Philosophy
   2. Mysticism
   3. Occultism (Esoteric traditions of Alchemy, Hermetism, Kabbalah)
5. References and Further Reading

1. History and Development of Christian Platonism up to Pseudo-Dionysius

Born within a 500-year old Graeco-Roman culture, Christianity received a pervasive influence from the then 400-year old Platonist tradition very early on. Despite the official outlawing of so-called pagan philosophy in the 6th century, Platonism or Neoplatonism, continued to maintain a dynamically evolving influence for the ensuing thousand years within the sphere of Christianity and beyond that, interest in Platonism is waxing strong today. In general, the prominent early Christian Platonists were men already possessing a classical Graeco-Roman culture and schooled in the Middle Platonic tradition and who would subsequently convert to Christianity thus bringing their background and knowledge to the service of their new faith. Already, Philo of Alexandria (20 BC – 40 AD) had developed an extensive Middle Platonic interpretation of the Jewish scriptures (scriptural symbology, logos theology, moral philosophy, etc.). With the solid framework provided by Philo, Alexandria became the home of the first Christian Platonists: Clement (160 – 220) and Origen (185 -253) who both in their own way crafted a considerable system of correspondences between Platonism and Christianity. The influence of Neoplatonism can be seen with the Cappadocian fathers Basil (330-379), Gregory Nazianzus (329 – 389), and Gregory of Nyssa (331/40 – ca. 395); as well as Synesius of Cyrene (373? – 414). Origen’s influence continued with the fathers of the Egyptian desert, Macarius (295 – 386), Evagrius Pontus (345 – 399), and John Cassian (+350). The Neoplatonic influence appears in the Latin Church with Marius Victorinus (281/291- ?), Ambrose (354 – 450), Augustine (354 – 430),  and Boethius (460? – 524). Philiponus (fl. 500?) is a Christian Neoplatonist who studied with the last teachers of the pagan Athenian school.

2. Mystery Schools, Gnosticism, Hermeticism, and the “Platonic Underground”

In accordance with his Neoplatonic background, Ps-Dionysius adopts the initiation language of the Mystery religions. Basically, the Mystery religions can be considered as the esoteric counterpart to the exoteric popular religions. The symbols and mythology of popular cults of worship are thought to contain an esoteric meaning which reveal a deeper mystical knowledge. The pledge of secrecy being integral to the Mystery religions, comparatively little information about them has come down to us. There seems to be a stock of similar myths, symbols, and ritual common to all of them and their influence was pervasive in both the Pagan and Christian world:

The Soul was the one subject, and the knowledge of the Soul the one object of all the ancient Mysteries. In the ‘Fall’ of PISTIS-SOPHIA, and her rescue by her Syzygy, JESUS, we see the ever-enacted drama of the suffering and ignorant Personality, which can only be saved by the immortal Individuality or rather by its own yearning towards IT (H. P. Blavatsky, “Commentary on the Pistis-Sophia,” in Collected Writings, Vol. XIII, The Theosophical Publishing House, Wheaton: 1982, p. 40).

The Neoplatonic schools at this period can be considered to represent a middle ground between the pagan esoteric cults  [Hellenic Mysteries, Oriental Mystery cults (Mithraism, Attis), Hermetism, Greek alchemists (Zosimos)] and the popular state forms of religious worship. Whether a Christian Neoplatonist such as Ps-Dionysius played a similar mediating role between the exoteric forms of Judeo-Christianity (popular Roman Catholic state religion) and esoteric Christianity (Gnosticism, Arianism, Docetism) would be a matter of conjecture, but what is interesting is how the Dionysian corpus formulates a creative philosophical synthesis that reflects a more open Christian position in a period when all the above-mentioned religious movements where in a very dynamic state of ferment and conflict which saw the rise of Christianity and the waning of Paganism.

3. The Works of Dionysius the Areopagite

There are five works ascribed to Dionysius:  The Divine Names, The Mystical Theology, The Celestial Hierarchy, The Ecclesiastical Hierarchy and his Epistles.  All of these works are interrelated and, taken together, form a complex whole.  Paul Rorem gives a very good overview of how these works unfold:

The point here is that not all affirmations concerning God are equally inappropriate; they are arranged in a descending order of decreasing congruity.  Affirmative theology begins with the loftier, more congruous comparisons and then proceeds “down” to the less appropriate ones.  Thus, as the author reminds us, The Theological Representations [not extant] began with God’s oneness and proceeded down into the multiplicity of affirming the Trinity and the incarnation.  The Divine Names then affirmed the more numerous designations for God which come from mental concepts, while The Symbolic Theology [not extant] “descended” into the still more pluralized realm of sense perception and its plethora of symbols for the deity.  This pattern of descending affirmations and ascending negations can be interpreted in terms of late Neoplatonism’s “procession” from the One down into plurality and the “return” of all back to the One. In the “return,” not all negations concerning God are equally appropriate; the attributes to be negated are arranged in an ascending order of decreasing incongruity, first considering and negating the lowest or most obviously false statements about God and then moving up to deny these that may seem more congruous.  Thus the first to be denied are the perceptible attributes, starting with The Mystical Theology, Chapter 4, which therefore previews the two subsequent treatises on perceptible symbols, The Celestial Hierarchy and The Ecclesiastical Hierarchy.  Chapter 2 of the former work will continue the theme of negating and transcending symbols, namely, interpreting first the most incongruous of the perceptible symbols attributed to the celestial, whether to the angels or to God.  The anagogical or uplifting method of interpretation in these two treatises incorporates into itself the principles of negative theology.  Both the spatial, material depiction of the angels in the scriptures and also the temporal, sequential images of God in the liturgy must be transcended in the ascent from the perceptible to the intelligible.  Thus, “as we climb higher,” Chapter 5 of The Mystical Theology denies and moves beyond all our concepts or “conceptual” attributes of God and concludes by abandoning all speech and thought, even negations. (Pseudo-Dionysius, The Complete Works,  New York: Paulist Press 1987, p.140 note).

a. The Divine Names (13 Chapters)

Chapter 1 Dionysius the Elder to Timothy the Fellow Elder:  What the goal of this discourse is, and the tradition regarding the divine names. A general introduction in which God is considered omniscient, beyond all human understanding and description and therefore can only be expressed through symbols, names which are found in the scriptures.  One can approach the truth of God through contemplation of the Divine Symbols. The conception of God is a philosophical one, akin to  the One, or the Good of  Neoplatonism, and not  anthropomorphic Old Testament God of popular theology.

Chapter 2 Concerning the unified and differentiated Word of God, and what the divine unity and differentiation is.
The Neoplatonic concept of emanation finds its counterpart in the “divine procession.”  Jesus Christ is considered to be a mystery that is beyond human contemplation.

Chapter 3 The power of praying, concerning the blessed Hierotheus, piety and our theology. Here the author speaks of his teacher Hierotheus and refers to a work of his entitled “Elements of Theology” which is not extant.

Chapter 4 Concerning “God,” “Light,” “Beautiful,” “Love,” “Ecstasy,” and “Zeal” and that evil is neither a being, nor from a being, nor in beings. Here begins the metaphysical explanations of the Divine Names taken from the scriptures.  Also explained is the mystical concept of “yearning” for union with the Good and the Beautiful.  The philosophical explanation of evil is evidently much more Platonic than the anthropomorphic concept of evil as expressed by the conventional church dogma. (The parallels on the discussion of evil to the De Malorum Subsistentia of Proclus provided the initial clues in proving the pseudonymous authorship.)

Chapter 5 Concerning “Being” and also concerning paradigms. The metaphysical causes of Being are discussed.

Chapter 6 Concerning “Life.” The transcendent, absolute, eternal nature of life is dealt with.

Chapter 7 Concerning “Wisdom,” “Mind,” “Truth,” “Faith.” The basis of a divine, transcendent wisdom where humans derive their intelligence and understanding through participation with the Divine Mind is discussed.

Chapter 8 Concerning “Power,” “Righteousness,” “Salvation,” “Redemption,” and also inequality. This chapter deals with the ordering of the universe according to divine laws by which a transcendent order maintains the dynamic harmony of all things.

Chapter 9 Concerning greatness and smallness, sameness and difference, similarity and dissimilarity, rest, motion, equality. It is shown how the fundamental unity of God can be seen in the multiplicity of the universe at the macrocosmic and microcosmic levels.

Chapter 10 Concerning “Omnipotent,”  “Ancient of Days,” and also concerning “Eternity” and “Time.” This chapter deals with the philosophical aspects of time and eternity.

Chapter 11 Concerning “Peace,” and what is intended by “being itself,” “power itself” and things said in this vein. The intelligent harmony which brings things together in a communion of concord is discussed.

Chapter 12 Concerning “Holy of Holies,” “King of Kings,” “Lord of Lords,” “God of Gods.” Holy of Holies deals with Purity; Kingship, with law and order; Lordship, stability through possession of the Good and the Beautiful, God, Providence which sees everything.

Chapter 13 Concerning “Perfect”  and “One.” Here is a synthesis of the whole work, returning to the idea of the One as discussed in Neoplatonic terms.

b. The Mystical Theology (5 Chapters)

Chapter 1 An explanation of Ps-Dionysius’ negative theology in which one rises to high levels of divine contemplation by defining God by what it is not because it is beyond assertion and denial.

Chapter 2 How one should be united to, and attribute praises to the cause of all things which is beyond all things.

Chapter 3 What are the affirmative theologies and what are the negative.  The higher we rise towards the transcendent, the more language fails to describe it.

Chapter 4 That the supreme cause of every perceptible thing is not itself perceptible.  The negative theology begins by denying it all formal existence perceptible by the senses.

Chapter 5 It is stated that the supreme Cause of every conceptual thing is not itself conceptual.  We are to apprehend it by rising to the highest concepts and then going beyond where neither assertion nor denial can be attributed to it.

c. The Celestial Hierarchy (15 Chapters)

Chapter 1 That every divine illumination, descending with goodness and according to different modes to the object of its providence, remains nonetheless simple, and indeed unifies what it illumines. The treatise begins with an explanation of the value of the symbol as a representation of spiritual essences.

Chapter 2 It is appropriate to reveal the mysteries of God and of heaven with symbols without resemblance. Here it is explained that the many images and symbols in the Bible are not meant to be taken at dead letter face value.  As man is incapable of contemplating Divine Truth directly, our divinely inspired ancestors have left us symbols adapted to our capacity of understanding which help us to raise our consciousness to the understanding and contemplation of the divine truths;  the second function of the symbol is that it also serves as a veil to these sacred truths for those who it would be imprudent to reveal these things to.  The value of the symbol therefore depends on the person’s capacity to penetrate its secrets.

Chapter 3 In what does the Hierarchy consist of and what is its use. The notion of hierarchy is that seeing that not everyone can equally directly contemplate and participate in the supreme cause, there is therefore a great chain of hierarchies emanating from the most spiritual origins down to the most material planes.  To undertake the divine ascension, there are intermediaries for every level of reality like the steps on a ladder.  The higher hierarchies, receiving a more direct illumination, can transmit that light to the lower hierarchies at the level they are able to perceive it and the higher hierarchies also serve as an accessible image of the transcendent, an example for the hierarchy immediately below, whose members can contemplate in order to rise to a higher level.  The closer a hierarchy is to the source of divine light, the greater the degree of purity and simplicity and resemblance to the source.

Chapter 4 What the names given to the angels signify. An interesting point concerning the hierarchies is that no human being can directly contemplate the ultimate Source.  Even Moses did not have a direct vision of God but rather a vision adapted to his level of perception.  It is shown how the incarnation of Christ was done in accord with the hierarchical order of angels.

Chapter 5 Why are all the celestial essences distinctly called angels. On the hierarchical scales the angels are at the lowest degree of the hierarchy.  This is because the higher levels contain all the illumination and power of the lower levels; but the lower do not have the same level of participation with the higher.  Therefore the term angel is used because, in a sense, it is the lowest common denominator.

Chapter 6 What is the first order of the celestial essences, what is the middle order and what is the inferior order.
All the names of the hierarchies appear in the scriptures.  They are divided into three groups of three hierarchies each:

First – Seraphim, Cherubim and Thrones
Second – Dominions, Virtues and Powers
Third – Principalities, Archangels and Angels

Chapter 7 Of the Seraphim, the Cherubim and the Thrones and of the first hierarchy that they constitute. The meaning of the first three angelic hierarchies are as follows:

Seraphim – Fire, “Those who burn”
Cherubim – Messengers of knowledge, Wisdom
Thrones – Seat of God

Chapter 8 Of the Dominions, the Virtues and the Powers and the middle hierarchy that they constitute. The meaning of the second order of the hierarchies are as follows:

Dominions – Justice
Virtues – Courage, Virility
Powers – Order, Harmony

Chapter 9 Of the Principalities, the Archangels and the Angels and of the last hierarchy that they constitute. The meaning of the third order are as follows:

Principalities – Authority
Archangels – Unity
Angels – Revelation, messengers

Chapter 10 Recapitulation and conclusion concerning the proper ordering of the angelic hierarchy. Each order, therefore has in itself three orders – first, middle and last.  It is said that none of the orders are totally perfect; all the hierarchies thus mutually participate in a constant  march, striving towards perfection.

Chapter 11 Why all the celestial essences receive in common the name of the celestial powers. The celestial powers have three qualities – essence, power and act.

Chapter 12 Why do the highest of high priests receive the name of angels. Why are priests called angels?  Because although the lower orders do not participate of the higher orders per se, the illuminations of the higher orders do radiate all the way through to the lowest orders in a gradually decreasing brightness, therefore it can be said that the lower can receive the light of the higher in an indirect manner.

Chapter 13 Why is it said that it is the Seraphim that purified the prophet Isaiah. In the Bible, when Isaiah was purified by a Seraphim, it is not to be understood that he was in direct contact with such an immeasurably high order; what is meant is that the illuminating properties and powers of the order of the Seraphim had descended through the several intermediary orders to purify Isaiah.  It is a question of opacity and translucency in regards to the light.  Light shines and its rays can pass through substances depending on its degree of translucency, will reflect more or less of the light.  This analogy applies to human consciousness in relation to divine light.

Chapter 14 What does the number attributed to the angels signify. It is stated that there are an immeasurable number of angels in every order, and therefore a truly infinite number of angels are acting in the various planes of the universe.  There is an angel overlooking the welfare of every nation as well.

Chapter 15 What are the figurative images of the angelic powers. This chapter discusses the various symbols in reference to the angelic functions such as fire; man; infant; sacred clothes and instruments; air, wind and clouds; metals and stones; animals.

d. The Ecclesiastical Hierarchy (7 Chapters)

Chapter 1 What is the tradition of the ecclesiastical hierarchy and what is its purpose. It is explained how the tradition began initially with a divine transmission of sacred symbols and forms which were thereafter transmitted to succeeding generations.

Chapter 2. 1 The rite of illumination.
The goal of the hierarchy is “greatest likeness and union with god through obedience of the commandments and doing the sacred acts.”  And the first initiation is the divine birth, meaning birth to a spiritual life.

2.2 A postulant who wishes to enter the spiritual life has a sponsor who presents him to the hierarch.  The postulant goes through various ritual gestures including being anointed with oil and immersed in water three times.  It is a baptism.

2.3 This is a practical applications of the symbols.  The rituals are not merely functional gestures but are meant to convey actual transformation processes in the candidates consciousness.  For example, the immersion in water symbolizes a dissolution of the old material way of life to reemerge into the spiritual which is further symbolized by putting on bright new clothes and fragrant ointments. Firm opposition to whatever hinders our communion, brave resolution in striving to uplift oneself and a will for victory over the forces of death and destruction is stressed.

Chapter 3.1 The rite of the synaxis.
Or the Eucharist.  What these initiation operations do is by granting communion, it gives the participants an inner unity by gathering together the divided  and scattered  fragments of our consciousness.

3.2 Mystery of the synaxis or communion. The Eucharist is the ritual re-enactment of the last supper.

3.3 A symbolic explanation of the Eucharist is explained as well as the value of Christ’s example that we should strive to imitate.  There is also different levels of participation in the ceremonies according to one’s level of purification, clarity of vision, and freedom from fantasies.

Chapter 4.1 The ritual of ointment and what is perfected by it. The ointment is the third of the three holy sacraments explained.

4.2 Mystery of the sacred ointment. This consists in consecrating the sacred ointment used for almost all the sacraments of sanctification and rites of consecration.

4.3 Perfecting and consecrating with ointment – symbolizes a visitation of the Divine Spirit.

Chapter 5.1 Concerning the clerical orders, powers, activities, and consecrations. Here are three orders which are a reflection of the triple order of the celestial hierarchy.  And these orders have a further triple division.  Furthermore they have a triple power of purification, illumination  and perfection.

1-  Hierarchs – Sanctification of clerical orders, consecration of ointment  and rite of purification and consecration of the Holy butter.
2-  Priests – Illumination
3-  Deacons –  Purification

5.2 The mystery of the clerical consecrations of the three orders. The various rites of consecration of the three orders are explained.

5.3 The hierarch does not work the consecration through his own personal authority but is rather an intermediary for the Divine Powers.

Chapter 6.1 Concerning the orders of those being initiated. Various categories of candidates who will approach the mysteries are detailed:

1-  The three orders of candidates receiving direct instruction (incubation, instruction).
2-  Those who fell away and are returning to the church.
3-  Those who are weak, fearful and require strengthening.
4-  Those who have lived a life of  sin and need  sanctification.
5-  Those who are attentive to the spiritual life but lack firmness in practice.

There is then an intermediate level – those ready to enter upon the path of contemplation; candidate priests for illumination.
There is also the order of monks – they are considered purified and have complete power and holiness in its own activities within the hierarchies.

6.2 Mystery of the consecration of a monk. The monastic profession and tonsure is explained.

6.3 Renunciation of all activities in act and thought that distract from the sacred life is  stressed.  The correspondence of purification, illumination and perfection with the celestial hierarchies is explained.

Chapter 7.1 The rite for the dead. Dying is called a sacred rebirth.

7.2 Mystery regarding those who died sacredly. The rites are explained for those who belong to the orders.

7.3 The rewards are not equal for all. One will live in a state of blessedness in the afterlife corresponding to the degree of saintliness one has achieved in material life. This  treatise closes on a point concerning baptism of children.  The idea of baptism at a young age is that it is considered good to develop sacred habits at a young age and the baptism is effected only if it is agreed that the child be entrusted to a spiritual parent who will afterwards provide them with a religious education.

e. The Epistles (10 Letters)

Letter 1 – To the monk, Gaius– Deals with negative theology.

Letter 2 – To the monk, Gaius– Is a discussion on the Good.

Letter 3 – To the monk, Gaius– Deals with the mystery of Jesus.

Letter 4 – To the monk, Gaius– Of the transcendent character of Jesus; the humanity of Jesus is emphasized.

Letter 5 – To Dorotheus, deacon– Deals with negative theology.

Letter 6 – To Sosipater, Priest– Denis is against the denunciation of cults who express a different point of view than Christianity.

Letter 7 – To Polycarp, a hierarch–  Regarding a discussion with Apollophanes, a sophist, Ps-Dionysius counsels not to refute his opinions but simply establish the truth as clearly as he can and let the validity of his explanations stand for themselves.  There is a reference to the Mithraic cult as well as to various Christian miracles.

Letter 8 To Demophilus, a monk–  This is the longest of the letters and concerns a monk who turned away a repenting sinner who wished to return to the church.  Ps-Dionysius disapproves  of the monk’s actions and extols the virtue of meekness, kindness and tolerance in which reason governs anger.  There are also many details concerning the practical functioning of the ecclesiastical hierarchy and the authority and respect that the respective ranks should command.  The letter ends with a personal relating of a miraculous vision of a certain Carpos illustrating the  mercifulness of Jesus.

Letter 9 To Titus, Hierarch–  A question concerning the symbolism of the mixing bowl and food and drink as spiritual nourishment is dealt with.

Letter 10 To John the theologian– In this letter, words of comfort and support to an exiled apostle are conveyed.

4. The Dionysian Influence

The Dionysian corpus has had an wide influence on various aspects of Christian thought. The following list is divided into three general currents of influence:  philosophy, mysticism and occultism. By no means comprehensive, this list aims to simply give a general overview of some prominent thinkers in the Christian Platonist tradition. The three categories are very general and the categorization loose, as many people on this list could easily overlap into several categories.

a. Philosophy

Maximus Confessor (580 – 662), Alcuin (730 – 806), John Scotus Eriugena (fl. 850), Michael Psellus (1018 – 1096), Hugh of St-Victor (+1141), Richard of St-Victor (+1173), Thomas Aquinas (1125 – 1274), Thiery of Chartres (fl. 1142 -1150), Robert Grosseteste (1175 – ca. 1225?) Bonaventure (1221 – 1274), Gemisthos Plethon (ca. 1370? – 1450), Nicholas of Cusa (1401 – 1464), Denis the Carthusian (1402 – 1471), Marsilio Ficino (1433 – 1499), Lefebvre d’Etaples (1436 -1520), Thomas Vaughan (1622 – 1666).

b. Mysticism

Bernard of Clairvaux (1091 -1153), Hildegarde of Bingen (1098 – 1179), Jacopone da Todi (1128 –  1306), Meister Eckhart (1260 – 1327), John Tauler (1300 -1361), Henry Suso (ca. 1295 – 1365), John Ruysbroeck (1293 – 1381), Henry de Mayle (ca. 1360 – 1415), Catherine of Sienna (1347 -1380), Jean Gerson (1363 – 1409), Francisco de Orsuna (+1540), Teresa of Avila (1515 – 1582), John of the Cross (1515 – 1582), Augustine Baker (1575 -1641), unknown author of the Cloud of Unknowing (ca. 1350 – 1395)

c. Occultism (Esoteric traditions of Alchemy, Hermetism, Kabbalah)

Albert the Great (1206 – 1240), Roger Bacon (1210/14 – ca. 1292), Dante (1265 – 1321), Ramon Lully (1232 – 1316?), Johannes Reuchlin (1455 -1522), Johannes Trithemius (1462 -1516), Pico de la Mirandola (1463 – 1494), Francesco Giorgi (1466 -1540),  Cornelius Agrippa (1486 – 1534), John Dee (1537 -1608), Giordano Bruno (1548 – 1600), Robert Fludd (1574-1637) Jacob Boehme (1575 – 1624), William Law (1686 -1761), Eckhartausen (1752 -1803), Louis-Claude de St-Martin (1743 -1803), William Blake (1757 -1827).

5. References and Further Reading

• Dillon, John, The Middle Platonists, Duckworth, Great Britain, 1977.
• Ferguson, Everett  (ed.), Encyclopedia of Early Christianity, Garland Publishing, New York, 1990.
• Finan, Thomas; Twaney, Vincent (eds.), The Relationship between Neoplatonism and Christianity, Four Courts Press, Dublin, 1992.
• Luibheid, Colm (transl.), Pseudo-Dionysius: The Complete Works, Paulist Press (Classics of Western Spirituality), New York, 1987.
• Livraga, Jorge Angel, Manuel d’Introduction aux philosophies d’orient et d’occident, Nouvelle Acropole, France.
• O’Leary, Dominic J., Neoplatonism and Christian Thought, State University Press, New York, 1982.
• Underhill, Evelyn, Mysticism, Meridian, Noonday Press, New-York, 1955.
• Yates, Frances A., Giordano Bruno and the Hermetic Tradition, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London. 1964.

Author Information

Mark Lamarre
Email: marklamarre@hotmail.com
U. S. A.

Protagoras (fl. 5th c. B.C.E.)

Protagoras of Abdera was one of several fifth century Greek thinkers (including also Gorgias, Hippias, and Prodicus) collectively known as the Older Sophists, a group of traveling teachers or intellectuals who were experts in rhetoric (the science of oratory) and related subjects. Protagoras is known primarily for three claims (1) that man is the measure of all things (which is often interpreted as a sort of radical relativism) (2) that he could make the “worse (or weaker) argument appear the better (or stronger)” and (3) that one could not tell if the gods existed or not. While some ancient sources claim that these positions led to his having been tried for impiety in Athens and his books burned, these stories may well have been later legends. Protagoras’ notion that judgments and knowledge are in some way relative to the person judging or knowing has been very influential, and is still widely discussed in contemporary philosophy. Protagoras’ influence on the history of philosophy has been significant. Historically, it was in response to Protagoras and his fellow sophists that Plato began the search for transcendent forms or knowledge which could somehow anchor moral judgment. Along with the other Older Sophists and Socrates, Protagoras was part of a shift in philosophical focus from the earlier Presocratic tradition of natural philosophy to an interest in human philosophy. He emphasized how human subjectivity determines the way we understand, or even construct, our world, a position which is still an essential part of the modern philosophic tradition.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Career
3. Doctrines
   1. Orthoepeia
   2. Man-Measure Statement
   3. Agnosticism
4. Social Consequences and Immediate Followers
5. Influence
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources
      

1. Life

Surprising little is known of Protagoras’ life with any certainty. Our main sources of information concerning Protagoras are:

1. Plato (427-347 B.C.E.): Protagoras is a leading character in Plato’s dialogue Protagoras and Protagoras’ doctrines are discussed extensively in Plato’s Theaetetus. Plato’s dialogues, however, are a mixture of historical account and artistic license, much in the manner of the comic plays of the period. Moreover, Protagoras died when Plato was quite young and Plato may have depended on not entirely reliable second-hand evidence for his understanding of Protagoras.
2. Diogenes Laertius (third century C.E.): Diogenes’ Lives of the Philosophers is probably our single most extensive source for many early Greek philosophers’ works and biographies. Unfortunately, his work was compiled over six hundred years after Protagoras’ death and is an uncritical compilation of materials from a wide variety of sources, some reliable, some not, and many hopelessly garbled.
3. Sextus Empiricus (fl. late 2nd century C.E.): Sextus Empiricus was a skeptic of the Pyrrhonian school. Sextus wrote several books criticizing the dogmatists (non-skeptics). His treatment of Protagoras is somewhat favorable, but since his purpose is to prove the superiority of Pyrrhonism to all other philosophies,we cannot trust him to be “objective” in a modern sense; moreover, like Diogenes, he wrote several hundred years after Protagoras’ death and may not have had completely reliable sources.

The first step in understanding Protagoras is to define the general category of “sophist,” a term often applied to Protagoras in antiquity. In the fifth century, the term referred mainly to people who were known for their knowledge (for example, Socrates, the seven sages) and those who earned money by teaching advanced pupils (for example, Protagoras, Prodicus) and seemed to be a somewhat neutral term, although sometimes used with pejorative overtones by those who disapproved of the new ideas of the so-called “Sophistic Enlightenment”. By the fourth century the term becomes more specialized, limited to those who taught rhetoric, specifically the ability to speak in assemblies or law courts. Because sophistic skills could promote injustice (demagoguery in assemblies, winning unjust lawsuits) as well as justice (persuading the polis to act correctly, allowing the underprivileged to win justice for themselves), the term “sophist” gradually acquired the negative connotation of cleverness not restrained by ethics. Conventionally, the term “Older Sophist” is restricted to a small number of figures known from the Platonic dialogues (Protagoras, Gorgias, Prodicus, Hippias, Euthydemus, Thrasymachus and sometimes others). Whether these figures actually had some common body of doctrines is uncertain. At times scholars have tended to lump them together in a group, and attribute to them all a combination of religious skepticism, skill in argument, epistemological and moral relativism, and a certain degree of intellectual unscrupulousness. These characteristics, though, were probably more typical of their fourth century followers than of the Older Sophists themselves, who tended to agree with and follow generally accepted moral codes, even while their more abstract speculations undermined the epistemological foundations of traditional morality.

When we separate Protagoras from general portraits of “sophistic”, as most scholars (for example, the ones listed below in the bibliography) recommend, our information about him is relatively sparse. He was born in approximately 490 B. C. E. in the town of Abdera in Thrace and died c. 420 B. C. E. (place unknown). He traveled around Greece earning his living primarily as a teacher and perhaps advisor and lived in Athens for several years, where he associated with Pericles and other rich and influential Athenians. Pericles invited him to write the constitution for the newly founded Athenian colony of Thurii in 444 B. C. E. Many later legends developed around the life of Protagoras which are probably false, including stories concerning his having studied with Democritus, his trial for impiety, the burning of his books, and his flight from Athens.

2. Career

If our knowledge of Protagoras’ life is sparse, our knowledge of his career is vague. Protagoras was probably the first Greek to earn money in higher education and he was notorious for the extremely high fees he charged. His teaching included such general areas as public speaking, criticism of poetry, citizenship, and grammar. His teaching methods seemed to consist primarily of lectures, including model orations, analyses of poems, discussions of the meanings and correct uses of words, and general rules of oratory. His audience consisted mainly of wealthy men, from Athens’ social and commercial elites. The reason for his popularity among this class had to do with specific characteristics of the Athenian legal system.

Athens was an extremely litigious society. Not only were various political and personal rivalries normally carried forward by lawsuits, but one special sort of taxation, know as “liturgies” could result in a procedure known as an “antidosis” (exchange). A liturgy was a public expense (such as providinga ship for the navy or supporting a religious festival) assigned to one of the richest men of the community. If a man thought he had been assigned the liturgy unfairly, because there was a richer man able to undertake it, he could bring a lawsuit either to exchange his property with the other man’s or to shift the burden of the liturgy to the richer man. Since Athenians had to represent themselves in court rather than hiring lawyers, it was essential that rich men learn to speak well in order to defend their property; if they could not do so, they would be at the mercy of anyone who wanted to extort money from them. While this made the teachings of Protagoras extremely valuable, it also led a certain conservative faction (for example, the comic playwright Aristophanes) to distrust him, in the same way that people now might distrust a slick lawyer.

3. Doctrines

Protagoras’ doctrines can be divided into three groups:

1. Orthoepeia: the study of the correct use of words
2. Man-measure statement: the notion that knowledge is relative to the knower
3. Agnosticism: the claim that we cannot know anything about the gods

a. Orthoepeia

Perhaps because the practical side of his teaching was concerned with helping students learn to speak well in the courtroom, Protagoras was interested in “orthoepeia” (the correct use of words). Later sources describe him as one of the first to write on grammar (in the modern sense of syntax) and he seems interested in the correct meaning of words, a specialty often associated with another sophist, Prodicus, as well. In the Protagoras, the Platonic dialogue named after the famous sophist which has both Protagoras and Prodicus as participants, Protagoras is shown interpreting a poem of Simonides, with special concern for the issue of the relationship between the writer’s intent and the literal meanings of the words. This method of interpretation was one which would be especially useful in interpreting laws and other written witnesses (contracts, wills, and so forth) in the courtroom. Unfortunately, we don’t have any actual writings by Protagoras on the topic.

b. Man-Measure Statement

Of the book titles we have attributed to Protagoras, only two, “Truth” (or “Refutations”) and “On the Gods” are probably accurate. Of Protagoras’ works, only a few brief quotations embedded in the works of later authors have survived. (The quotations of and reports about Protagoras below are referred to by their ‘Diels-Kranz,’ or ‘DK’ number, the usual way of referring to such fragments and testimonia. The Diels-Kranz numbering system is explained here.) Of Protagoras’ ipsissima verba (actual words, as opposed to paraphrases), the most famous is the homo-mensura (man-measure) statement (DK80b1): “Of all things the measure is man, of the things that are, that [or “how”] they are, and of things that are not, that [or “how”] they are not.” This precise meaning of this statement, like that of any short extract taken out of context, is far from obvious, although the long discussion of it in Plato’s Theaetetus gives us some sense of how ancient Greek audiences interpreted it. The test case normally used is temperature. If Ms. X. says “it is hot,” then the statement (unless she is lying) is true for her. Another person, Ms. Y, may simultaneously claim “it is cold.” This statement could also be true for her. If Ms. X normally lives in Alaska and Ms. Y in Florida, the same temperature (e. g. 25 Celsius) may seem hot to one and cool to the other. The measure of hotness or coldness is fairly obviously the individual person. One cannot legitimately tell Ms. X she does not feel hot — she is the only person who can accurately report her own perceptions or sensations. In this case, it is indeed impossible to contradict as Protagoras is held to have said (DK80a19). But what if Ms. Y, in claiming it feels cold, suggests that unless the heat is turned on the pipes will freeze? One might suspect that she has a fever and her judgment is unreliable; the measure may still be the individual person, but it is an unreliable one, like a broken ruler or unbalanced scale. In a modern scientific culture, with a predilection for scientific solutions, we would think of consulting a thermometer to determine the objective truth. The Greek response was to look at the more profound philosophical implications.

Even if the case of whether the pipes will freeze can be solved trivially, the problem of it being simultaneously hot and cold to two women remains interesting. If this cannot be resolved by determining that one has a fever, we are presented with evidence that judgments about qualities are subjective. If this is the case though, it has alarming consequences. Abstractions like truth, beauty, justice, and virtue are also qualities and it would seem that Protagoras’ dictum would lead us to conclude that they too are relative to the individual observer, a conclusion which many conservative Athenians found alarming because of its potential social consequences. If good and bad are merely what seem good and bad to the individual observer, then how can one claim that stealing or adultery or impiety or murder are somehow wrong? Moreover, if something can seem both hot and cold (or good and bad) then both claims, that the thing is hot and that the thing is cold, can be argued for equally well. If adultery is both good and bad (good for one person and bad for another), then one can construct equally valid arguments for and against adultery in general or an individual adulterer. What will make a case triumph in court is not some inherent worth of one side, but the persuasive artistry of the orator. And so, Protagoras claims he is able to “make the worse case the better” (DK80b6). The oratorical skills Protagoras taught thus had potential for promoting what most Athenians considered injustice or immorality.

c. Agnosticism

While the pious might wish to look to the gods to provide absolute moral guidance in the relativistic universe of the Sophistic Enlightenment, that certainty also was cast into doubt by philosophic and sophistic thinkers, who pointed out the absurdity and immorality of the conventional epic accounts of the gods. Protagoras’ prose treatise about the gods began “Concerning the gods, I have no means of knowing whether they exist or not or of what sort they may be. Many things prevent knowledge including the obscurity of the subject and the brevity of human life.” (DK80b4)

4. Social Consequences and Immediate Followers

As a consequence of Protagoras’ agnosticism and relativism, he may have considered that laws (legislative and judicial) were things which evolved gradually by agreement (brought about by debate in democratic assemblies) and thus could be changed by further debate. This position would imply that there was a difference between the laws of nature and the customs of humans. Although Protagoras himself seemed to respect, and even revere the customs of human justice (as a great achievement), some of the younger followers of Protagoras and the other Older Sophists concluded that the arbitrary nature of human laws and customs implies that they can be ignored at will, a position that was held to be one of the causes of the notorious amorality of such figures as Alcibiades.

Protagoras himself was a fairly traditional and upright moralist. He may have viewed his form of relativism as essentially democratic — allowing people to revise unjust or obsolete laws, defend themselves in court, free themselves from false certainties — but he may equally well have considered rhetoric a way in which the elite could counter the tendencies towards mass rule in the assemblies. Our evidence on this matter is unfortunately minimal.

The consequences of the radical skepticism of the sophistic enlightenment appeared, at least to Plato and Aristophanes, among others, as far from benign. In Aristophanes’ play, the Clouds, a teacher of rhetoric (called Socrates, but with doctrines based to a great degree on those of the Sophists, and possibly directed specifically at Protagoras or his followers) teaches that the gods don’t exist, moral values are not fixed, and how to make the weaker argument appear the stronger. The result is moral chaos — the main characters (Strepsiades and his son Pheidippides) in Clouds are portrayed as learning clever tricks to enable them to cheat their creditors and eventually abandoning all sense of conventional morality (illustrated by Pheidippides beating his father on stage and threatening to beat his mother). Although no one accused Protagoras himself of being anything other than honest — even Plato, who disapproved of his philosophical positions, portrays him as generous, courteous, and upright — his techniques were adopted by various unscrupulous characters in the following generation, giving sophistry the bad name it still has for clever (but fallacious) verbal trickery.

5. Influence

Protagoras’ influence on the history of philosophy has been significant. Historically, it was in response to Protagoras and his fellow sophists that Plato began the search for transcendent forms or knowledge which could somehow anchor moral judgment. Along with the other Older Sophists and Socrates, Protagoras was part of a shift in philosophical focus from the earlier Presocratic tradition of natural philosophy to an interest in human philosophy. He emphasized how human subjectivity determines the way we understand, or even construct, our world, a position which is still an essential part of the modern philosophic tradition.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary sources

• Aristophanes. Clouds. Intro. and trans. by Carol Poster. In Aristophanes 3, ed. David Slavitt and Palmer Bovie. Philadelphia PA: University of Pennsylvania Press, 1999: 85-192.
• Diels, Hermann. Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Rev. Walther Kranz. Berlin: Weidmann, 1972-1973.
• Diogenes Laertius. Lives Of Eminent Philosophers. Trans. R. D. Hicks. 2 vols. Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 1959.
• Plato. Plato II: Laches, Protagoras, Meno, Euthydemus. Trans. W. R. M. Lamb. Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 1967.
• Plato. Plato VII: Theaetetus, Sophist. Trans. H. N. Fowler. Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 1925.
• Sextus Empiricus. Sextus Empiricus. Trans. R. G. Bury. 4 vols. Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 1953-59.
• Sprague, Rosamund Kent, ed. The Older Sophists: A Complete Translation by Several Hands. Columbia SC: University of South Carolina Press, 1972.

b. Secondary sources

• Guthrie, W. K. C. The Sophists. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1971
• de Romilly, Jaqueline. The Great Sophists In Periclean Athens. Trans. Janet Lloyd. Oxford: The Clarendon Press, 1992.
• Kennedy, George. The Art Of Persuasion In Greece. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
• Kerferd, G. B. The Sophistic Movement. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.
• Rankin, H. D. Sophists, Socratics & Cynics. London: Croom Helm, 1983.
• Schiappa, Edward. Protagoras and Logos. Columbia S.C.: University of South Carolina Press 1991.

Author Information

Carol Poster
Email: cposter@english.fsu.edu
Florida State University
U. S. A.

Philo of Alexandria (c. 20 B.C.E.—40 C.E.)

Philo of Alexandria, a Hellenized Jew also called Judaeus Philo, is a figure that spans two cultures, the Greek and the Hebrew. When Hebrew mythical thought met Greek philosophical thought in the first century B.C.E. it was only natural that someone would try to develop speculative and philosophical justification for Judaism in terms of Greek philosophy. Thus Philo produced a synthesis of both traditions developing concepts for future Hellenistic interpretation of messianic Hebrew thought, especially by Clement of Alexandria, Christian Apologists like Athenagoras, Theophilus, Justin Martyr, Tertullian, and by Origen. He may have influenced Paul, his contemporary, and perhaps the authors of the Gospel of John (C. H. Dodd) and the Epistle to the Hebrews (R. Williamson and H. W. Attridge). In the process, he laid the foundations for the development of Christianity in the West and in the East, as we know it today. Philo’s primary importance is in the development of the philosophical and theological foundations of Christianity. The church preserved the Philonic writings because Eusebius of Caesarea labeled the monastic ascetic group of Therapeutae and Therapeutrides, described in Philo’s The Contemplative Life, as Christians, which is highly unlikely. Eusebius also promoted the legend that Philo met Peter in Rome. Jerome (345-420 C.E.) even lists him as a church Father. Jewish tradition was uninterested in philosophical speculation and did not preserve Philo’s thought. According to H. A. Wolfson, Philo was a founder of religious philosophy, a new habit of practicing philosophy. Philo was thoroughly educated in Greek philosophy and culture as can be seen from his superb knowledge of classical Greek literature. He had a deep reverence for Plato and referred to him as “the most holy Plato” (Prob. 13). Philo’s philosophy represented contemporary Platonism which was its revised version incorporating Stoic doctrine and terminology via Antiochus of Ascalon (ca 90 B.C.E.) and Eudorus of Alexandria, as well as elements of Aristotelian logic and ethics and Pythagorean ideas. Clement of Alexandria even called Philo “the Pythagorean.”  But it seems that Philo also picked up his ancestral tradition, though as an adult, and once having discovered it, he put forward the teachings of the Jewish prophet, Moses, as “the summit of philosophy” (Op. 8), and considered Moses the teacher of Pythagoras (b. ca 570 B.C.E.) and of all Greek philosophers and lawgivers (Hesiod, Heraclitus, Lycurgus, to mention a few). For Philo, Greek philosophy was a natural development of the revelatory teachings of Moses. He was no innovator in this matter because already before him Jewish scholars attempted the same. Artapanus in the second century B.C.E identified Moses with Musaeus and with Orpheus. According to Aristobulus of Paneas (first half of the second century B.C.E.), Homer and Hesiod drew from the books of Moses which were translated into Greek long before the Septuagint.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Philo’s Works and Their Classification
3. Technique of Exposition
4. Emphasis on Contemplative Life and Philosophy
5. Philosophy and Wisdom: a Path to Ethical Life
6. Philo’s Ethical Doctrine
7. Philo’s Mysticism and Transcendence of God
8. Source of Intuition of the Infinite Reality
9. Philo’s Doctrine of Creation
   1. Philo’s Model of Creation
   2. Eternal Creation
10. Doctrine of Miracles: Naturalism and Comprehension
11. Doctrine of the Logos in Philo’s Writings
    1. The Utterance of God
    2. The Divine Mind
    3. God’s Transcendent Power
    4. First-born Son of God
    5. Universal Bond: in the Physical World and in the Human Soul
    6. Immanent Reason
    7. Immanent Mediator of the Physical Universe
    8. The Angel of the Lord, Revealer of God
    9. Multi-Named Archetype
    10. Soul-Nourishing Manna and Wisdom
    11. Intermediary Power
    12. “God”
    13. Summary of Philo’s Concept of the Logos
12. List of abbreviations to Philo’s works
13. Editions of Philo’s works and their translations
14. Major Works on Philo

1. Life

Very little is known about the life of Philo. He lived in Alexandria, which at that time counted, according to some estimates, about one million people and included largest Jewish community outside of Palestine. He came from a wealthy and the prominent family and appears to be a leader in his community. Once he visited Jerusalem and the temple, as he himself stated in Prov. 2.64. Philo’s brother, Alexander, was a wealthy, prominent Roman government official, a custom agent responsible for collecting dues on all goods imported into Egypt from the East. He donated money to plate the gates of the temple in Jerusalem with gold and silver. He also made a loan to Herod Agrippa I, grandson of Herod the Great.  Alexander’s two sons, Marcus and Tiberius Julius Alexander were involved in Roman affairs. Marcus married Bernice,  the daughter of Herod Agrippa I, who is mentioned in Acts (25:13, 23; 26:30). The other son, Tiberius Julius Alexander, described by Josephus as “not remaining true to his ancestral practices” became procurator of the province of Judea (46-48 C.E.) and prefect of Egypt (66-70 C.E.). Philo was involved in the affairs of his community which interrupted his contemplative life (Spec. leg. 3.1-6), especially during the crisis relating to the pogrom which was initiated in 38 C.E. by the prefect Flaccus, during the reign of emperor Gaius Caligula. He was elected to head the Jewish delegation, which apparently included his brother Alexander and nephew Tiberius Julius Alexander, and was sent to Rome in 39-40 B.C.E. to see the emperor. He reported the events in his writings Against Flaccus and The Embassy to Gaius.

2. Philo’s Works and Their Classification

The major part of Philo’s writings consists of philosophical essays dealing with the main themes of biblical thought that present a systematic and precise exposition of his views. One has the impression that he attempted to show that the philosophical Platonic or Stoic ideas were nothing but the deductions made from the biblical verses of Moses. Philo was not an original thinker, but he was well acquainted with the entire range of Greek philosophical traditions through the original texts. If there are gaps in his knowledge, they are rather in his Jewish tradition as evidenced by his relying on the Greek translation of the Hebrew Bible. In his attempt to reconcile the Greek way of thinking with his Hebrew tradition he had antecedents such as Pseudo-Aristeas and Aristobulus.

Philo’s works are divided into three categories:

1. The first group comprises writings that paraphrase the biblical texts of Moses: On Abraham, On the Decalogue, On Joseph, The Life of Moses, On the Creation of the World, On Rewards and Punishments, On the Special Laws, On the Virtues. A series of works include allegorical explanations of Genesis 2-41: On Husbandry, On the Cherubim, On the Confusion of Tongues, On the Preliminary Studies, The Worse Attacks the Better, On Drunkenness, On Flight and Finding, On the Giants, Allegorical Interpretation (Allegory of the Law), On the Migration of Abraham, On the Change of Names, On Noah’s Work as a Planter, On the Posterity and Exile of Cain, Who is the Heir, On the Unchangeableness of God, On the Sacrifices of Abel and Cain, On Sobriety, On Dreams. Here belong also: Questions and Answers on Genesis and Questions and Answers on Exodus (aside from fragments preserved only in Armenian).

2. A series of works classified as philosophical treatises: Every Good Man is Free (a sequel of which had the theme that every bad man is a slave, which did not survive); On the Eternity of the World; On Providence (except for lengthy fragments preserved in Armenian); Alexander or On Whether Brute Animals Possess Reason (preserved only in Armenian) and called in Latin De Animalibus (On the Animals); a brief fragment De Deo (On God), preserved only in Armenian is an exegesis of Genesis 18, and belongs to the Allegory of the Law.

3. The third group includes historical-apologetic writings: Hypothetica or Apologia Pro Judaeos which survives only in two Greek extracts quoted by Eusebius. The first extract is a rationalistic version of Exodus giving a eulogic account of Moses and a summary of Mosaic constitution contrasting its severity with the laxity of the gentile laws; the second extract describes the Essenes. The other apologetic essays include Against Flaccus, The Embassy to Gaius, and On the Contemplative Life. But all these works are related to Philo’s explanations of the texts of Moses.

3. Technique of Exposition

Philo uses an allegorical technique for interpretation of the Hebrew myth and in this he follows the Greek tradition of Theagenes of Rhegium (second half of the sixth century B.C.E.). Theagenes used this approach in defense of Homer’s theology against the detractors. He said that the myths of gods struggling with each other referred to the opposition between the elements; the names of gods were made to refer to various dispositions of the soul, e.g., Athena was reflection, Aphrodite, desire, Hermes, elocution. Anaxagoras, too, explained the Homeric poems as discussions of virtue and justice. The Sophist Prodicus of Ceos (b. 470 B.C.E.), contemporary of Socrates, interpreted the gods of Homeric stories as personifications of those natural substances that are useful to human life [e.g., bread and Demeter, wine and Dionysus, water and Poseidon, fire and Hephaestus].  He also employed ethical allegory. His treatise, The Seasons, contains a Parable of Heracles, paraphrased in Xenophon’s Memorabilia (2.1.21-34), which tells the story of Heracles who, at crossroad, was attracted by Virtue and Vice in the form of two women of great stature (Sacr. 20-44). The allegory was used by the cynic Antisthenes (contemporary of Plato) and Diogenes the Cynic.  Stoics expanded the Cynics’ use of Homeric allegory in the interest of their philosophical system. Using this allegorical method, Philo seeks out the hidden message beneath the surface of any particular text and tries to read back a new doctrine into the work of the past. In a similar way Plutarch allegorized the ancient Egyptian mythology giving it a new meaning. But in some aspects of Jewish life Philo defends the literal interpretation of his tradition as in the debate on circumcision or the Sabbath (Mig. 89-93; Spec. leg. 1.1-11). Though he acknowledges the symbolic meaning of these rituals, he insists on their literal interpretation.

4. Emphasis on Contemplative Life and Philosophy

The key emphasis in Philo’s philosophy is contrasting the spiritual life, understood as intellectual contemplation, with the mundane preoccupation with earthly concerns, either as an active life or as a search for pleasure. Philo disdained the material world and physical body (Spec. leg. 3.1-6). The body was for Philo as for Plato,  “an evil and a dead thing” (LA 3.72-74; Gig. 15), wicked by nature and a plotter against the soul (LA 3.69). But it was a necessary evil, hence Philo does not advocate a complete abnegation from life. On the contrary he advocates fulfilling first the practical obligations toward men and the use of mundane possessions for the accomplishment of praiseworthy works (Fug. 23-28; Plant. 167-168). Similarly he considers pleasure indispensable and wealth useful, but for a virtuous man they are not a perfect good (LA 3.69-72). He believed that men should steer themselves away from the physical aspect of things gradually. Some people, like philosophers, may succeed in focusing their minds on the eternal realities. Philo believed that man’s final goal and ultimate bliss is in the “knowledge of the true and living God” (Decal. 81; Abr. 58; Praem. 14); “such knowledge is the boundary of happiness and blessedness” (Det. 86). To him, mystic vision allows our soul to see the Divine Logos (Ebr. 152) and achieve a union with God (Deut. 30:19-20; Post. 12). In a desire to validate the scripture as an inspired writing, he often compares it to prophetic ecstasy (Her. 69-70). His praise of the contemplative life of the monastic Therapeutae in Alexandria attests to his preference of bios theoreticos over bios practicos. He adheres to the Platonic picture of the souls descending into the material realm and that only the souls of philosophers are able to come to the surface and return to their realm in heaven (Gig. 12-15). Philo adopted the Platonic concept of the soul with its tripartite division. The rational part of the soul, however, is breathed into man as a part of God’s substance. Philo speaks figuratively  “Now, when we are alive, we are so though our soul is dead and buried in our body, as if in a tomb. But if it were to die, then our soul would live according to its proper life being released from the evil and dead body to which it is bound” (Op. 67-69; LA 1.108).

5. Philosophy and Wisdom: a Path to Ethical Life

Philo differentiated between philosophy and wisdom.  To him philosophy is “the greatest good thing to men” (Op. 53-54), which they acquired because of a gift of reason from God (Op. 77). It is a devotion to wisdom, and a way to acquire the highest knowledge, “an attentive study of wisdom.” Wisdom in turn is “the knowledge of all divine and human things, and of the respective causes of them” that is, according to Philo, contained in the Torah (Congr. 79). Hence it follows that Moses, as the author of the Torah, “had reached the very summit of philosophy” and “had learnt from the oracles of God the most numerous and important of the principles of nature” (Op. 8). Moses was also the interpreter of nature (Her. 213). By saying this Philo wanted to indicate that human wisdom has two origins: one is divine, the other is natural (Her. 182). Moreover, that Mosaic Law is not inconsistent with nature. A single law, the Logos of nature governs the entire world (Jos. 28-31) and its law is imprinted on the human mind (Prob. 46-47). Because of this we have a conscience that affects even wicked persons (QG 4.62). Wisdom is a consummated philosophy and as such has to be in agreement with the principles of nature (Mos. 2.48; Abr. 16; Op. 143; Spec. leg. 2.13; 3.46-47, 112, 137; Virt. 18). The study of philosophy has as its end “life in accordance with nature” and following the “path of right reason” (Mig. 128). Philosophy prepares us to a moral life, i.e., “to live in conformity with nature” (Prob. 160). From this follows that life in accordance with nature hastens us towards virtues (Mos. 2. 181; Abr. 60, Spec. leg. 1.155), and an unjust man is the one “who transgresses the ordinances of nature” (Spec. leg. 4.204; Cf. Decal. 132; Virt. 131-132; Plant. 49; Ebr. 142; Agr. 66). Thus Philo does not discount human reason, but contrasts only the true doctrine which is trust in God with uncertain, plausible, and unreliable reasoning (LA 3.228-229).

6. Philo’s Ethical Doctrine

Philo’s ethical doctrine is Stoic in its essence and includes the active effort to achieve virtue, the model of a sage to be followed, and practical advice concerning the achievement of the proper right reason and a proper emotional state of rational emotions (eupatheia). To Philo man is basically passive and it is God who sows noble qualities in the soul, thus we are instruments of God (LA 2.31-32; Cher. 127-128). Still man is the only creature endowed with freedom to act though his freedom is limited by the constitution of his mind. As such he is responsible for his action and “very properly receives blame for the offences which he designedly commits.” This is so because he received a faculty of voluntary motion and is free from the dominion of necessity (Deus 47-48). Philo advocates the practice of virtue in both the divine and the human spheres. Lovers only of God and lovers only of men are both incomplete in virtue. Philo advocates a middle harmonious way (Decal. 106-110; Spec. leg. 4. 102). He differentiates four virtues: wisdom, self-control, courage, and justice (LA 1.63-64). Human dispositions Philo divides into three groups – the best is given the vision of God, the next has a vision on the right i.e., the Beneficent or Creative Power whose name is God, and the third has a vision on the left, i.e., the Ruling Power called Lord (Abr. 119-130). Felicity is achieved in the culmination of three values: the spiritual, the corporeal, and the external (QG 3.16). Philo adopts the Stoic wise man as a model for human behavior. Such a wise man should imitate God who was impassible (apathes) hence the sage should achieve a state of apatheia, i.e., he should be free of irrational emotions (passions), pleasure, desire, sorrow, and fear, and should replace them by rational or well-reasoned emotions (eupatheia), joy, will, compunction, and caution. In such a state of eupatheia, the sage achieves a serene, stable, and joyful disposition in which he is directed by reason in his decisions (QG 2.57; Abr. 201-204; Fug. 166-167; Mig. 67). But at the same time Philo claims that the needs of the body should not be neglected and rejects the other extreme, i.e., the practice of austerities. Everything should be governed by reason, self-control, and moderation. Joy and pleasure do not have intrinsic values, but are by-products of virtue and characterize the sage (Fug. 25-34; Det. 124-125; LA 80).

7. Philo’s Mysticism and Transcendence of God

Mysticism is a doctrine that maintains that one can gain knowledge of reality that is not accessible to sense perception or to reason. It is usually associated with some mental and physical training and in the theistic version it involves a sensation of closeness to or unity with God experienced as temporal and spatial transcendence. According to Philo, man’s highest union with God is limited to God’s manifestation as the Logos. It is similar to a later doctrine of intellectual contact of our human intellect with the transcendent intellect developed by Alexander of Aphrodisias and Ibn Rushd and different from the Plotinian doctrine of the absorption into the ineffable one. The notion of the utter transcendence of the First Principle probably goes back as far as Anaximander who postulated the Indefinite (apeiron) as this Principle (arche) and could be found in Plato’s concept of the Good,  but the formulation is accredited to Speusippus, the successor of Plato in the Academy.  Philo’s biblical tradition in which one could not name or describe God was the major factor in accepting the Greek Platonic concepts and emphasis on God’s transcendence. But this position is rather alien to biblical and rabbinical understanding. In the Bible, God is represented in a “material” and “physical” way. Philosophically, however, Philo differentiated between the existence of God, which could be demonstrated, and the nature of God which humans are not able to cognize. God’s essence is beyond any human experience or cognition, therefore it can be described only by stating what God is not (via negativa) or by depriving him of any attribute of sensible objects and putting God beyond any attribute applicable to a sensible world (via eminentiae) because God alone is a being whose existence is his essence (Det. 160). Philo states in many places that God’s essence is one and single, that he does not belong to any class or that there is in God any distinction of genus and species. Therefore, we cannot say anything about his qualities “For God is not only devoid of peculiar qualities, but he is likewise not of the form of man” (LA 1.36); he “is free from distinctive qualities” (LA 1.51; 3.36; Deus 55). Strictly speaking, we cannot make any positive or negative statements about God: “Who can venture to affirm that … he is a body, or that he is incorporeal, or that he has such and such distinctive qualities, or that he has no such qualities? … But he alone can utter a positive assertion respecting himself, since he alone has an accurate knowledge of his own nature” (LA 3.206). Moreover, since the essence of God is single, therefore its property must be one which Philo denotes as acting “Now it is an especial attribute of God to create, and this faculty it is impious to ascribe to any created being” (Cher. 77). The expression of this act of God, which is at the same time his thinking, is his Logos (Prov. 1.7; Sacr. 65; Mos. 1.283). Though God is hidden, his reality is made manifest by the Logos that is God’s image (Somn. 1.239; Conf. 147-148) and by the sensible universe, which in turn is the image of the Logos, that is “the archetypal model, the idea of ideas” (Op. 25). Because of this we can perceive God’s existence, though we cannot fathom his essence. But there are degrees and levels to our cognizance of God. Those at the summit and the highest level may grasp the unity of the powers of God, at the lower level people recognize the Logos as the Regent Power, and those still at the lowest level, immersed in the sensible world are unable to perceive the intelligible reality (Fug. 94; Abr. 124-125). Steps in mystic experience involve a realization of human nothingness, a realization that the one who acts is God alone, and abandonment of our sense of perception (Her. 69-71; Plant. 64; Conf. 95; Ebr. 152). A mystic state will produce a sensation of tranquility, and stability; it appears suddenly and is described as a sober intoxication (Gig. 49; Sacr. 78; Somn. 1.71; Op. 70-71).

8. Source of Intuition of the Infinite Reality

According to Philo the highest knowledge man may have is the knowledge of infinite reality which is not accessible by the normal senses, but by unmediated intuition of divinity. Humans were endowed with the mind, i.e., ability to reason and the outward senses. We received the first in order that we might consider the things that are discernable only by the intellect, the end of which is truth, and the second for the perception of visible things the end of which is opinion. Opinions are unstable, based on probability, and untrustworthy. Thus by this divine gift men are able to come to a conclusion about the existence of the divinity. They can do it in two ways: one is the apprehension of God through contemplation of his creation and forming a “conjectural conception of the Creator by a probable train of reasoning”(Praem. 43). And in the process the soul may climb the ladder to perfection by using natural means i.e., natural dispositions, instruction, i.e., being educated to virtue, or by meditation. The other is a direct apprehension by being instructed by God himself when the mind elevates itself above the physical world and perceives the uncreated One through a clear vision (Praem. 28-30, 40-66; LA 97-103). This vision is accessible to the “purified mind” to which God appears as One. To the mind uninitiated in the mysteries, unable to apprehend God alone by himself, but only through his actions, God appears as a triad constituted by him and his two powers, Creative and Royal (Abr. 97-103). Such a direct vision of God is not dependent on revelation but is possible because we have an impression of God in our mind, which is nothing but a tiny fragment of the Logos pervading the whole universe, not separated from its source, but only extended (Det. 90; Gig. 27; LA 1.37; Mut. 223; Spec. leg. 4.123). And we receive this portion of the Divine Mind at birth being endowed with a mind which makes us resemble God (Op. 65-69). At birth two powers enter every soul, the salutary (Beneficent) and the destructive (Unbounded). The world is created through these same powers. The creation is accomplished when ” the salutary and beneficent (power) brings to an end the unbounded and destructive nature.” Similarly, one or the other power may prevail in humans, but when the salutary power “brings to an end the unbounded and destructive nature” humans achieve immortality. Thus both the world and humans are a mixture of these powers and the prevailing one has the moral determination: “For the souls of foolish men have the unbounded and destructive rather than the powerful and salutary [power], and it is full of misery when it dwells with earthly creatures. But the prudent and noble [soul] receives the powerful and salutary [power] and, on the contrary, possesses in itself good fortune and happiness” (QE 1.23). Philo evidently analyzes these two powers on two levels. One is the divine level in which the Unlimited or the Unbounded is a representation of God’s infinite and immeasurable goodness and creativity. The Logos keeps it in balance through the Limit. The other level is the human one where the Unlimited or the Unbounded represents destruction and everything morally abhorrent. Human reason is able, however, to maintain in it some kind of balance. This mind, divine and immortal, is an additional and differentiating part of the human soul which animates man just like the souls of animals which are devoid of mind. The notion of God’s existence is thus imprinted in our mind that needs only some illumination to have a direct vision of God (Abr. 79-80; Det. 86-87; LA 1.38). Thus we can arrive at it through the dialectical reasoning as apprehension of the First Principle. Philo differentiates two modes for perceiving God, an inferential mode and a direct mode without mediation: “As long, therefore, as our mind still shines around and hovers around, pouring as it were a noontide light into the whole soul, we, being masters of ourselves, are not possessed by any extraneous influence” (Her. 264). Thus this direct mode is not in any way a type of inspiration or inspired prophecy; it is unlike “inspiration” when a “trance” or a “heaven-inflicted madness” seizes us and divine light sets as it happens “to the race of prophets” (Her. 265).

9. Philo’s Doctrine of Creation

Philo attempts to bridge the Greek “scientific” or rational philosophy with the strictly mythical ideology of the Hebrew scriptures. As a basis for the “scientific” approach he uses the worldview presented by Plato in Timaeus which remained influential in Hellenistic times. The characteristic feature of the Greek scientific approach is the biological interpretation of the physical world in anthropocentric terms, in terms of purpose and function that may apply to biological and psychological realities but may not be applied to the physical world. Moreover, Philo operates often on two levels: the level of mythical Hebraic religious tradition and the level of philosophical speculation in the Greek tradition. Nevertheless, Philo attempts to harmonize the Mosaic and Platonic accounts of the generation of the world by interpreting the biblical story using Greek scientific categories and concepts. He elaborates a religious-philosophical worldview that became the foundation for the future Christian doctrine. Philo’s doctrine of creation is intertwined with his doctrine of God and it answers two crucial questions: 1. Was the world created ex nihilo or from primordial matter? 2. Was creation a temporal act or is it an eternal process?

a. Philo’s Model of Creation

Though Philo’s model of creation comes from Plato’s Timaeus, the direct agent of creation is not God himself (described in Plato as Demiurge, Maker, Artificer), but the Logos. Philo believes that the Logos is “the man of God” (Conf. 41) or the shadow of God that was used as an instrument and a pattern of all creation (LA 3.96). The Logos converted unqualified, unshaped preexistent matter, which Philo describes as “destitute of arrangement, of quality, of animation, of distinctive character and full of disorder and confusion,” (Op. 22) into four primordial elements:

For it is out of that essence that God created everything, without indeed touching it himself, for it was not lawful for the all-wise and all-blessed God to touch materials which were all misshapen and confused, but he created them by the agency of his incorporeal powers, of which the proper name is Ideas, which he so exerted that every genus received its proper form (LA 1.329).

According to Philo, Moses anticipated Plato by teaching that water, darkness, and chaos existed before the world came into being (Op. 22).  Moses, having reached the philosophy summit, recognized that there are two fundamental principles of being, one, “an active cause, the intellect of the universe.” The other is passive, “inanimate and incapable of motion by any intrinsic power of its own” (Op. 8-9), matter, lifeless and motionless. But Philo is ambiguous in such statements as these: “God, who created all things, not only brought them all to light, but he has even created what before had no existence, not only being their maker, but also their founder” (Somn. 1.76; Op. 81); “God who created the whole universe out of things that had no previous existence…” (LA 3.10). It seems that Philo does not refer here to God’s creation of the visible world ex nihilo but to his creation of the intelligible Forms prior to the formation of the sensible world (Spec. leg. 1.328). Philo reasons that by analogy to the biblical version of the creation of man in the image of God, so the visible world as such must have been created in the image of its archetype present in the mind of God. “It is manifest also, that that archetypal seal, which we call that world which is perceptible only to the intellect, must itself be the archetypal model, the Idea of Ideas, the Logos of God” (Op. 25). In his doctrine of God Philo interprets the Logos, which is the Divine Mind as the Form of Forms (Platonic), the Idea of Ideas or the sum total of Forms or Ideas (Det. 75-76). The Logos is an indestructible Form of wisdom. Interpreting the garment of the high priest (Exod. 28:34; 36) Philo states: “But the seal is an Idea of Ideas, according to which God fashioned the world, being an incorporeal Idea, comprehensible only by the intellect” (Mig. 103). The invisible intelligible world which was used by the Logos as a model for creation or rather formation of the visible world from the (preexisting) unformed matter was created in the mind of God: “The incorporeal world then was already completed, having its seat in the Divine Logos and the world, perceptible by the external senses, was made on the model of it” (Op. 36). Describing Moses’ account of the creation of man, Philo states also that Moses calls the invisible Divine Logos the Image of God (Op. 24; 31; LA 1.9). Forms, though inapprehensible in essence, leave an impress and a copy and procure qualities and shapes to shapeless things and unorganized matter. Mind can grasp the Forms by longing for wisdom. “The desire for wisdom alone is continual and incessant, and it fills all its pupils and disciples with famous and most beautiful doctrines” (Spec. leg. 1-45-50). Creation thus took place from preexistent shapeless matter (Plato’s Receptacle) which is “the nurse of all becoming and change”  and for this creation God used the Forms which are his powers (Spec. leg. 1.327-329). This may seem a controversial point whether the primordial matter was preexistent or was created ex nihilo. Philo’s view is not clearly stated and there are seemingly contradictory statements. In some places Philo states, “for as nothing is generated out of nothing, so neither can anything which exists be destroyed as to become non-existence” (Aet. 5-6). The same is repeated in his De Specialibus legibus: “Being made of us [i.e. elements] when you were born, you will again be dissolved into us when you come to die; for it is not the nature of any thing to be destroyed so as to become nonexistent, but the end brings it back to those elements from which its beginnings come” (Spec. 1.266). The resolution of this seeming controversy is to be found in Philo’s theory of eternal creation, which is described next in connection with the Logos as the agent of creation. Philo, being a strict monist, could not accept the existence of independent and eternal preexistent matter (however disorganized and chaotic) as Plato did.

b. Eternal Creation

Philo denies the Aristotelian conclusion coming, according to him, from the superficial observation that the world existed from eternity, independent of any creative act. “For some men, admiring the world itself rather than the Creator of the world, have represented it as existing without any maker, and eternal, and as impiously and falsely have represented God as existing in a state of complete inactivity” (Op. 7). He elaborates instead his theory of the eternal creation (Prov. 1.6-9), as did Proclus (410-485 C.E.) much later in interpreting Plato.  Proclus brilliantly demonstrated that even in the theistic system the world though generated must be eternal, because the “world is always fabricated … is always becoming to be.”  Proclus believed, as did Philo, that the corporeal world is always coming into existence but never possesses real being. Thus God, according to Philo, did not begin to create the world at a certain moment, but he is “eternally applying himself to its creation” (Prov. 1.7; Op. 7; Aet. 83-84).

But God is the creator of time also, for he is the father of his father, and the father of time is the world, which made its own mother the creation of time, so that time stands towards God in the relation of a grandson; for this world is a younger son of God, inasmuch as it is perceptible by the outward sense, for the only son he speaks of as older than the world, is Idea, and this is not perceptible by the intellect, but having thought the other worthy of the rights of primogeniture, he has decided that it should remain with him; therefore, this younger son, perceptible by the external senses being set in motion, has caused the nature of time to shine forth, and to become conspicuous, so that there is nothing future to God, who has the very boundaries of time subject to him; for their life is not time, but the beautiful model of eternity; and in eternity nothing is past and nothing is future, but everything is present only (Deus. 31-32).

Philo contends that God thinks simultaneously with his acting or creating. “For God while he spake the word, did at the same moment create; nor did he allow anything to come between the Logos and the deed; and if one may advance a doctrine which is pretty nearly true, His Logos is his deed” (Sacr. 65; Mos.1.283). Thus any description of creation in temporal terms, e.g., by Moses, is not to be taken literally, but rather is an accommodation to the biblical language (Op. 19; Mut. 27; LA 2.9-13):

God is continuously ordering matter by his thought. His thinking was not anterior to his creating and there never was a time when he did not create, the Ideas themselves having been with him from the beginning. For God’s will is not posterior to him, but is always with him, for natural motions never give out. Thus ever thinking he creates, and furnishes to sensible things the principle of their existence, so that both should exist together: the ever-creating Divine Mind and the sense-perceptible things to which beginning of being is given (Prov. 1.7).

Thus Philo postulates a crucial modification to the Platonic doctrine of the Forms, namely that God himself eternally creates the intelligible world of Ideas as his thoughts. The intelligible Forms are thus the principle of existence to the sensible things which are given through them their existence. This simply means in mystical terms that nothing exists or acts except God. On this ideal model God then orders and shapes the formless matter through the agency of his Logos (Her. 134, 140) into the objects of the sensible world:

Now we must form a somewhat similar opinion of God [Philo makes an analogy to a plan of the city in the mind of its builder], who, having determined to found a mighty state, first of all conceived its form in his mind, according to which form he made a world perceptible only by the intellect, and then completed one visible to the external senses, using the first one as a model (Op. 19).

Philo claims a scriptural support for these metaphysics saying that the creation of the world was after the pattern of an intelligible world (Gen. 1:17) which served as its model. During the first day God created Ideas or Forms of heaven, earth, air (= darkness), empty space  (= abyss), water, pneuma (= mind), light, the intelligible pattern of the sun and the stars (Op. 29). There are, however, differences between Philo and Plato: according to Plato, there is no Form of space (chora). In Plato space is not apprehended by reason; rather it had its own special status in the world. Also pneuma as a Form of soul does not exist in the system of Plato. Plato designates this primordial unorganized state of matter a self-existing Receptacle; it is most stable and a permanent constituent: “It must be called always the same, for it never departs at all from its own character” (Plato, Timaeus 50b-c). Philo, being a strict monist could not allow even for a self-existing void so he makes its pattern an eternal idea in the divine mind. Before Philo there was no explicit theory of creation ex nihilo ever postulated in Jewish or Greek traditions. Both Philo and Plato do not explain how the reflections (eidola) of Forms are made in the world of senses. They do not attribute them to God or the Demiurge because it would be contrary to their conception of God as “good” and “desiring that all things should come as near as possible to being like himself.”  God could not create the copies of the Forms which should be “disordered.” It seems then that the primordial unorganized matter was spontaneously produced on the pattern of the Ideas. The Logos would shape the elements from this preexistent matter, first into heavy (or dense) and light (or rare) elements which were differentiated properly into water and earth, and air and fire (Her. 134-140; 143). As in Plato certain geometrical descriptions characterize Philo’s elements. Fire was characterized by a pyramid, air by an octahedron, water by an icosahedron, and earth by a cube (QG 3.49). In Plato’s theory too, one can envision a sort of automatic reflection of the Forms in the Receptacle due to the properties of Forms. God could not, according to Philo’s philosophy, create the preexistent matter. “And what God praised was not the materials which he had worked up in creation, destitute of life and melody, and easily dissolved, and moreover in their own intrinsic nature perishable, and out of proportion and full of iniquity, but rather his own skillful work, completed according to one equal and well-proportioned power and knowledge always alike and identical.” (Her. 160). Logically, God is for Philo indirectly the source of preexistent matter but Philo does not ascribe to God even the shaping of matter directly. In fact this unorganized matter never existed because it was simultaneously ordered into organized matter – the four elements from which the world is made.

10. Doctrine of Miracles: Naturalism and Comprehension

Closely connected with Philo’s doctrine of creation is his doctrine of miracles. His favorite statement is that “everything is possible with God.” This, however, does not mean that God can act outside the natural order of things or his own nature. Thus Philo emphasizes that God’s miraculous works are within the realm of the natural order. Doing this he extends the natural order to encompass the biblical miracles and tries to explain them by their coincidence with natural events. For example, the miracle at the Red Sea which he characterizes as a “mighty work of nature” (Mos. 1.165), or the plague of darkness as a total eclipse (Mos. 1.123), or the story of Balaam as an allegorical one (Cher. 32-35). This was the tendency inherited from some Stoics who attempted to explain miracles of divination as events preordered in nature by the divine power pervading it. Similarly Philo considers the biblical miracles as a part of the eternal pattern of the Logos acting in nature. Augustine considers miracles as implanted in the destiny of the cosmos since the time of its creation.  Philo and rabbinic literature emphasize the miraculous and marvelous character of nature itself. All natural things are wonderful, but are “despised by us by reason of our familiarity with them” and all things with which we are unaccustomed, make an impression on us “for the love of novelty”(Mos. 1.2-213). Even in modern Jewish teaching there is a tendency to explain the miraculous by the natural. Thus the one can find a certain discrepancy in Philo’s writing: on one hand Philo is rationalist and naturalist in the spirit of Greek philosophical tradition, on the other, he follows popular religion to preserve the biblical tradition. Philo emphasizes, however, that we are limited in our human capabilities to “comprehend everything” about the physical world, and it is better to “suspend our judgment” than to err:

But since we are found to be influenced in different manners by the same things at different times, we should have nothing positive to assert about anything, inasmuch as what appears has no settled or stationary existence, but is subject to various, and multiform, and ever-recurring changes. For it follows of necessity, since the imagination is unstable, that judgment formed by it must be unstable; and there are many reasons for this (Ebr. 170).

But we are able to comprehend things by comparing them with their opposites and thus arriving at their true nature. The same applies to what is virtue and to what is vice, and to what is just and good and to what is unjust and bad.

And, indeed, if any one considers everything that is in the world, he will be able to arrive at a proper estimate of its character, by taking it in the same manner; for each separate thing is by itself incomprehensible, but by a comparison with another thing, is easy to understand (Ebr. 187).

The same reasoning he extends to differences between national customs and ancient laws which vary according to countries, nations, cities, different villages, even private houses and instruction received by people from childhood.

And since this is the case, who is foolish enough and ridiculous as to affirm positively that such and such a thing is just, or wise, or honorable, or expedient? For whatever this man defines as such, some one else, who from his childhood has learnt a contrary lesson, will be sure to deny (Ebr. 197).

11. Doctrine of the Logos in Philo’s Writings

The pivotal and the most developed doctrine in Philo’s writings on which hinges his entire philosophical system, is his doctrine of the Logos. By developing this doctrine he fused Greek philosophical concepts with Hebrew religious thought and provided the foundation for Christianity, first in the development of the Christian Pauline myth and speculations of John, later in the Hellenistic Christian Logos and Gnostic doctrines of the second century. All other doctrines of Philo hinge on his interpretation of divine existence and action. The term Logos was widely used in the Greco-Roman culture and in Judaism. Through most schools of Greek philosophy, this term was used to designate a rational, intelligent and thus vivifying principle of the universe. This principle was deduced from an understanding of the universe as a living reality and by comparing it to a living creature. Ancient people did not have the dynamic concept of “function,” therefore, every phenomenon had to have an underlying factor, agent, or principle responsible for its occurrence. In the Septuagint version of the Old Testament the term logos (Hebrew davar) was used frequently to describe God’s utterances (Gen. 1:3, 6,9; 3:9,11; Ps. 32:9), God’s action (Zech. 5:1-4; Ps. 106:20; Ps. 147:15), and messages of prophets by means of which God communicated his will to his people (Jer. 1:4-19, 2:1-7; Ezek. 1:3; Amos 3:1). Logos is used here only as a figure of speech designating God’s activity or action. In the so-called Jewish wisdom literature we find the concept of Wisdom (hokhmah and sophia) which could be to some degree interpreted as a separate personification or individualization (hypostatization), but it is contrasted often with human stupidity. In the Hebrew culture it was a part of the metaphorical and poetic language describing divine wisdom as God’s attribute and it clearly refers to a human characteristic in the context of human earthly existence. The Greek, metaphysical concept of the Logos is in sharp contrast to the concept of a personal God described in anthropomorphic terms typical of Hebrew thought. Philo made a synthesis of the two systems and attempted to explain Hebrew thought in terms of Greek philosophy by introducing the Stoic concept of the Logos into Judaism. In the process the Logos became transformed from a metaphysical entity into an extension of a divine and transcendental anthropomorphic being and mediator between God and men. Philo offered various descriptions of the Logos.

a. The Utterance of God

Following the Jewish mythical tradition, Philo represents the Logos as the utterance of God found in the Jewish scripture of the Old Testament since God’s words do not differ from his actions (Sacr. 8; Somn. 1.182; Op. 13).

b. The Divine Mind

Philo accepts the Platonic intelligible Forms. Forms exist forever though the impressions they make may perish with the substance on which they were made (Det. 75-77; Mut. 80, 122. 146; Cher. 51). They are not, however, beings existing separately, only exist in the mind of God as his thoughts and powers. Philo explicitly identifies Forms with God’s powers. Those powers are his glory, though invisible and sensed only by the purest intellect. “And though they are by nature inapprehensible in their essence, still they show a kind of impression or copy of their energy and operation”(Spec. leg. 1.45-50). In his doctrine of God Philo interprets the Logos, which is the Divine Mind, as the Form of Forms (Platonic), the Idea of Ideas or the sum total of Forms or Ideas. Logos is the indestructible Form of wisdom comprehensible only by the intellect (Det. 75-76; Mig. 103).

c. God’s Transcendent Power

The Logos which God begat eternally because it is a manifestation of God’s thinking-acting (Prov. 1.7; Sacr. 65; Mos. 1.283), is an agent that unites two powers of the transcendent God. Philo relates that in an inspiration his own soul told him:

…that in the one living and true God there were two supreme and primary powers, Goodness [or Creative Power] and Authority [or Regent Power]; and that by his Goodness he had created every thing; and that by his Authority he governed all that he had created; and that the third thing which was between the two, and had the effect of bringing them together was the Logos, for it was owing to the Logos that God was both a ruler and good (Cher. 1.27-28).

And further, Philo finds in the Bible indications of the operation of the Logos, e.g., the biblical cherubim are the symbols of the two powers of God but the flaming sword (Gen. 3.24) is the symbol of the Logos conceived before all things and before all manifest (Cher. 1.27-28; Sacr. 59; Abr. 124-125; Her. 166; QE 2.68). Philo’s description of the Logos (the Mind of God) corresponds to the Greek concept of mind as hot and fiery. Philo obviously refers in these powers to the Unlimited (apeiron) and the Limited (peras) of Plato’s Philebus and earlier Pythagorean tradition, and they will later reappear in Plotinus as Nous. In Plato these two principles or powers operate at the metaphysical, cosmic (cosmic soul) and human (human soul) levels. Philo considers these powers to be inherent in transcendental God, and that God himself may be thought of as multiplicity in unity. The Beneficent (Creative) and Regent (Authoritative) Powers are called God and Lord, respectively. Goodness is Boundless Power, Creative, and God. The Regent Power is also Punitive Power and Lord (Her. 166). Creative Power, moreover, permeates the world, the power by which God made and ordered all things. Philo follows the ideas of the Stoics that nous pervades every part of the universe as it does the soul in us. Therefore, Philo asserts that the aspect of God which transcends his powers (which we have to understand to be the Logos) cannot be conceived of in terms of place but as pure being, “but that power of his by which he made and ordered all things called God, in accordance with the etymology of that name, enfolds the whole and passes through the parts of the universe” (Conf. 136-137). According to Philo, the two powers of God are separated by God himself who is standing above in the midst of them (Her. 166). Referring to Genesis 18: 2 Philo claims that God and his two Powers are in reality one. To the human mind they appear as a Triad, with God above the powers that belong to him: “For this cannot be so keen of spirit that, it can see Him who is above the powers that belong to Him, (namely) God, distinct from everything else. For so soon as one sets eyes on God, there also appear together with His being, the ministering powers, so that in place of one he makes the appearance of a triad (QG 4.2).” In addition to these two main powers, there are other powers of the Father and his Logos, including merciful and legislative (Fug. 94-95).

d. First-born Son of God

The Logos has an origin, but as God’s thought it also has eternal generation. It exists as such before everything else all of which are secondary products of God’s thought and therefore it is called the “first-born.” The Logos is thus more than a quality, power, or characteristic of God; it is an entity eternally generated as an extension, to which Philo ascribes many names and functions. The Logos is the first-begotten Son of the Uncreated Father: “For the Father of the universe has caused him to spring up as the eldest son, whom, in another passage, he [Moses] calls the first-born; and he who is thus born, imitating the ways of his father, has formed such and such species, looking to his archetypal patterns” (Conf. 63). This picture is somewhat confusing because we learn that in the final analysis the Creative Power is also identified with the Logos. The Creative Power is logically prior to the Regent Power since it is conceptually older. Though the powers are of equal age, the creative is prior because one is king not of the nonexistent but of what has already come into being (QE 2.62).  These two powers thus delimit the bounds of heaven and the world. The Creative Power is concerned that things that come into being through it should not be dissolved, and the Regent Power that nothing either exceeds or is robbed of its due, all being arbitrated by the laws of equality through which things continue eternally (QE 2.64). The positive properties of God may be subdivided into these two polar forces; therefore, the expression of the One is the Logos that constitutes the manifestation of God’s thinking, acting (Prov. 1.7; Sacr. 65; Mos. 1.283). According to Philo these powers of the Logos can be grasped at various levels. Those who are at the summit level grasp them as constituting an indivisible unity. At the two lower levels, respectively, are those who know the Logos as the Creative Power and beneath them those who know it as the Regent Power (Fug. 94-95; Abr. 124-125). The next level down represents those limited to the sensible world, unable to perceive the intelligible realities (Gig. 20). At each successively lower level of divine knowledge the image of God’s essence is increasingly more obscured. These two powers will appear again in Plotinus. Here Undefined or Unlimited Intelligible Matter proceeds from the One and then turns back to its source (Enneads 2.4.5; 5.4.2; 6.7.17)

e. Universal Bond: in the Physical World and in the Human Soul

The Logos is the bond holding together all the parts of the world. And as a part of the human soul it holds the body together and permits its operation. In the mind of a wise man thoroughly purified, it allows preservation of virtues in an unimpaired condition (Fug. 112). “And the Logos, which connects together and fastens every thing, is peculiarly full itself of itself, having no need whatever of any thing beyond” (Her. 188).

f. Immanent Reason

The reasoning capacity of a human mind is but a portion of the all-pervading Divine Logos. Mind is a special gift to humans from God and it has divine essence, therefore, as such, it is imperishable. By receiving this humans received freedom and the power of spontaneous will free from necessity (Deus. 47). Philo emphasizes that man “has received this one extraordinary gift, intellect, which is accustomed to comprehend the nature of all bodies and of all things at the same time.” Thus humanity resembles God in the sense of having free volition for unlike plants and other animals, the soul of man received from God the power of voluntary motion and in this respect resembles God (Deus. 48). This concept, that it is chiefly in the intellect and free volition that makes humans differ from other life forms, has a long history which can be traced to Anaxagoras and Aristotle.  Philo calls “men of God” those people who made God-inspired intellectual life their dominant issue. Such men “have entirely transcended the sensible sphere, and migrated to the intelligible world, and dwell there enrolled as citizens of the Commonwealth of Ideas, which are imperishable, and incorporeal … those who are born of God are priests and prophets who have not thought fit to mix themselves up in the constitutions of this world….”(Gig. 61). Philo writes in reference to the Old Testament expression that God “breathed into” (equivalent of “inspired” or “gave life to”) inanimate things that through this act God extended his spirit into humans (LA 1.37). Though his spirit is distributed among men it is not diminished (Gig. 27). The nature of the reasoning power in men is indivisible from the Divine Logos, but “though they are indivisible themselves, they divide an innumerable multitude of other things.” Just as the Divine Logos divided and distributed everything in nature (that is, it gave qualities to undifferentiated, primordial matter), so the human mind by exertion of its intellect is able to divide everything and everybody into an infinite number of parts. And this is possible because it resembles the Logos of the Creator and Father of the universe: “So that, very naturally, the two things which thus resemble each other, both the mind which is in us and that which is above us, being without parts and invisible, will still be able in a powerful manner to divide and distribute [comprehend] all existing things” (Her. 234-236; Det. 90). Uninitiated minds are unable to apprehend the Existent by itself; they only perceive it through its actions. To them God appears as a Triad — himself and his two Powers: Creative and Ruling. To the “purified soul,” however, God appears as One.

When, therefore, the soul is shone upon by God as if at noonday, and when it is wholly and entirely filled with that light which is appreciable only by the intellect, and by being wholly surrounded with its brilliancy is free from all shackle or darkness, it then perceives a threefold image of one subject, one image of the living God, and others of the other two, as if they were shadows irradiated by it …. but he claims that the term shadow is just a more vivid representation of the matter intended to be intimated. Since this is not the actual truth, but in order that one may when speaking keep as close to the truth as possible, the one in the middle is the Father of the universe, who in the sacred scripture is called by his proper name, I am that I am; and the beings on each side are those most ancient powers which are always close to the living God, one of which is called his Creative Power, and the other his Royal Power. And the Creative Power is God, for it is by this that he made and arranged the universe; and the Royal Power is the Lord, for it is fitting that the Creator should lord it over and govern the creature. Therefore, the middle person of the three, being attended by each of his powers as by body-guard, presents to the mind, which is endowed with the faculty of sight, a vision at one time of one being, and at another time of three; of one when the soul being completely purified, and having surmounted not only the multitude of numbers, but also the number two, which is the neighbour of the unit, hastens onward to that idea which is devoid of mixture, free from all combination, and by itself in need of nothing else whatever; and of three, when, not being as yet made perfect as to the important virtues, it is still seeking for initiation in those of less consequence, and is not able to attain to a comprehension of the living God by its own unassisted faculties without the aid of something else, but can only do so by judging of his deeds, whether as creator or as governor. This then, as they say, is the second best thing; and it no less partakes in the opinion which is dear to and devoted to God. But the first-mentioned disposition has no such share, but is itself the very God-loving and God-beloved opinion itself, or rather it is truth which is older than opinion, and more valuable than any seeming (Abr. 119-123).

The one category of enlightened people is able to comprehend God through a vision beyond the physical universe. It is as though they advanced on a heavenly ladder and conjectured the existence of God through an inference (Praem. 40). The other category apprehends him through himself, as light is seen by light. For God gave man such a perception “as should prove to him that God exists, and not to show him what God is.” Philo believes that even the existence of God “cannot possibly be contemplated by any other being; because, in fact, it is not possible for God to be comprehended by any being but himself ” (Praem. 39-40). Philo adds, “Only men who have raised themselves upward from below, so as, through the contemplation of his works, to form a conjectural conception of the Creator by a probable train of reasoning” (Praem. 43) are holy, and are his servants. Next Philo explains how such men have an impression of God’s existence as revealed by God himself, by the similitude of the sun (Mut. 4-6) a concept which he borrowed from Plato.  As light is seen in consequence of its own presence so, “In the same manner God, being his own light, is perceived by himself alone, nothing and no other being co-operating with or assisting him, a being at all able to contribute to pure comprehension of his existence; But these men have arrived at the real truth, who form their ideas of God from God, of light from light” (Praem. 45-46). As Plato and Philo had done, Plotinus later used this image of the sun. Thus the Logos, eternally created (begotten), is an expression of the immanent powers of God, and at the same time, it emanates into everything in the world.

g. Immanent Mediator of the Physical Universe

In certain places in his writings Philo accepts the Stoic theory of the immanent Logos as the power or Law binding the opposites in the universe and mediating between them, and directing the world. For example, Philo envisions that the world is suspended in a vacuum and asks, how is it that the world does not fall down since it is not held by any solid thing. Philo then gives the answer that the Logos extending himself from the center to its bounds and from its extremities to the center again, runs nature’s course joining and binding fast all its parts. Likewise the Logos prevents the earth from being dissolved by all the water contained within. The Logos produces a harmony (a favorite expression of the Stoics) between various parts of the universe (Plant. 8-10). Thus Philo sees God as only indirectly the Creator of the world: God is the author of the invisible, intelligible world which served as a model for the Logos. Philo says Moses called this archetypal heavenly power by various names: “the beginning, the image, and the sight of God”(LA 1.43). Following the views of Plato and the Stoics, Philo believed that in all existing things there must be an active cause, and a passive subject; and that the active cause Philo designates as the Logos. He gives the impression that he believed that the Logos functions like the Platonic “Soul of the World” (Aet. 84).

h. The Angel of the Lord, Revealer of God

Philo describes the Logos as the revealer of God symbolized in the Scripture (Gen. 31:13; 16:8; etc) by an angel of the Lord (Somn. 1.228-239; Cher. 1-3). The Logos is the first-born and the eldest and chief of the angels.

i. Multi-Named Archetype

Philo’s Logos has many names (Conf. 146).  Philo identifies his Logos with Wisdom of Proverbs 8:22 (Ebr. 31). Moreover, Moses, according to Philo called this Wisdom “Beginning,” “Image,” “Sight of God.” And his personal wisdom is an imitation of the archetypal Divine Wisdom. All terrestrial wisdom and virtue are but copies and representations of the heavenly Logos (LA 1.43, 45-46).

j. Soul-Nourishing Manna and Wisdom

God sends “the stream” from his Wisdom which irrigates God-loving souls; consequently they become filled with “manna.” Manna is described by Philo as a “generic thing” coming from God. It does not come from God directly, however: “the most generic is God, and next is the Logos of God, the other things subsist in word (Logos) only” (LA 2.86). According to Philo, Moses called manna “the most ancient Logos of God (Det. 118).” Next Philo explains that men are “nourished by the whole word (Logos) of God, and by every portion of it … Accordingly, the soul of the more perfect man is nourished by the whole word (Logos); but we must be contented if we are nourished by a portion of it” (LA 3.175-176). And “the Wisdom of God, which is the nurse and foster-mother and educator of those who desire incorruptible food … immediately supplies food to those which are brought forth by her … but the fountain of divine wisdom is borne along, at one time in a more gentle and moderate stream, and at another with greater rapidity and a more exceeding violence and impetuosity….(Det. 115-117). This Wisdom as the Daughter of God “has obtained a nature intact and undefiled both because of her own propriety and the dignity of him who begot her.” Having identified the Logos with Wisdom, Philo runs into a grammatical problem: in the Greek language “wisdom” (sophia) is feminine and “word” (logos) is masculine; moreover, Philo saw Wisdom’s function as masculine. So he explains that Wisdom’s name is feminine, but her nature is masculine:

Indeed all the virtues have women’s designations, but powers and activities of truly perfect men. For that which comes after God, even if it were the most venerable of all other things, holds second place, and was called feminine in contrast to the Creator of the universe, who is masculine, and in accordance with its resemblance to everything else. For the feminine always falls short and is inferior to the masculine, which has priority. Let us then pay no attention to the discrepancy in the terms, and say that the daughter of God, Wisdom, is both masculine and the father, inseminating and engendering in souls a desire to learn discipline, knowledge, practical insight, notable and laudable actions (Fug. 50-52).

k. Intermediary Power

The fundamental doctrine propounded by Philo is that of Logos as an intermediary power, a messenger and mediator between God and the world.

And the father who created the universe has given to his archangel and most ancient Logos a pre-eminent gift, to stand on the confines of both, and separate that which had been created from the Creator. And this same Logos is continually a suppliant to the immortal God on behalf of the mortal race, which is exposed to affliction and misery; and is also the ambassador, sent by the Ruler of all, to the subject race. And the Logos rejoices…. saying “And I stood in the midst, between the Lord and you” (Num. 16:48); neither being uncreated as God, nor yet created as you, but being in the midst between these two extremities, like a hostage, as it were, to both parties (Her. 205-206).

When speaking of the high priest, Philo describes the Logos as God’s son, a perfect being procuring forgiveness of sins and blessings: “For it was indispensable that the man who was consecrated to the Father of the world [the high priest] should have as a paraclete, his son, the being most perfect in all virtue, to procure forgiveness of sins, and a supply of unlimited blessings” (Mos. 2.134). Philo transforms the Stoic impersonal and immanent Logos into a being who was neither eternal like God nor created like creatures, but begotten from eternity. This being is a mediator giving hope to men and who “was sent down to earth.” God, according to Philo, sends “the stream of his own wisdom” to men “and causes the changed soul to drink of unchangeable health; for the abrupt rock is the wisdom of God, which being both sublime and the first of things he quarried out of his own powers.” After the souls are watered they are filled with the manna which “is called something which is the primary genus of everything. But the most universal of all things is God; and in the second place is the Logos of God”(LA 2.86). Through the Logos of God men learn all kinds of instruction and everlasting wisdom (Fug. 127-120). The Logos is the “cupbearer of God … being itself in an unmixed state, the pure delight and sweetness, and pouring forth and joy, and ambrosial medicine of pleasure and happiness” (Somn. 2.249). This wisdom was represented by the tabernacle of the Old Testament which was “a thing made after the model and in imitation of Wisdom” and sent down to earth “in the midst of our impurity in order that we may have something whereby we may be purified, washing off and cleansing all those things which dirty and defile our miserable life, full of all evil reputation as it is” (Her. 112-113). “God therefore sows and implants terrestrial virtue in the human race, being an imitation and representation of the heavenly virtue” (LA 1.45).

l. “God”

In three passages Philo describes the Logos even as God:

a.) Commenting on Genesis 22:16 Philo explains that God could only swear by himself (LA 3.207).
b.) When the scripture uses the Greek term for God ho theos, it refers to the true God, but when it uses the term theos, without the article ho, it refers not to the God, but to his most ancient Logos (Somn. 1.229-230).
c.) Commenting on Genesis 9:6 Philo states the reference to creation of man after the image of God is to the second deity, the Divine Logos of the Supreme being and to the father himself, because it is only fitting that the rational soul of man cannot be in relation to the preeminent and transcendent Divinity (QG 2.62).

Philo himself, however, explains that to call the Logos “God” is not a correct appellation (Somn.1.230). Also, through this Logos, which men share with God, men know God and are able to perceive Him (LA 1.37-38).

m. Summary of Philo’s Concept of the Logos

Philo’s doctrine of the Logos is blurred by his mystical and religious vision, but his Logos is clearly the second individual in one God as a hypostatization of God’s Creative Power – Wisdom. The supreme being is God and the next is Wisdom or the Logos of God (Op. 24). Logos has many names as did Zeus (LA 1.43,45,46), and multiple functions. Earthly wisdom is but a copy of this celestial Wisdom. It was represented in historical times by the tabernacle through which God sent an image of divine excellence as a representation and copy of Wisdom (Lev. 16:16; Her. 112-113). The Divine Logos never mixes with the things which are created and thus destined to perish, but attends the One alone. This Logos is apportioned into an infinite number of parts in humans, thus we impart the Divine Logos. As a result we acquire some likeness to the Father and the Creator of all (Her. 234-236). The Logos is the Bond of the universe and mediator extended in nature. The Father eternally begat the Logos and constituted it as an unbreakable bond of the universe that produces harmony (Plant. 9-10). The Logos, mediating between God and the world, is neither uncreated as God nor created as men. So in Philo’s view the Father is the Supreme Being and the Logos, as his chief messenger, stands between Creator and creature. The Logos is an ambassador and suppliant, neither unbegotten nor begotten as are sensible things (Her. 205). Wisdom, the Daughter of God, is in reality masculine because powers have truly masculine descriptions, whereas virtues are feminine. That which is in the second place after the masculine Creator was called feminine, according to Philo, but her priority is masculine; so the Wisdom of God is both masculine and feminine (Fug. 50-52). Wisdom flows from the Divine Logos (Fug. 137-138). The Logos is the Cupbearer of God. He pours himself into happy souls (Somn. 2.249). The immortal part of the soul comes from the divine breath of the Father/Ruler as a part of his Logos.

12. List of abbreviations to Philo’s works

Abr. De Abrahamo;
Aet. De Aeternitate Mundi;
Agr. De Agricultura;
Anim. De Animalibus;
Cher. De Cherubim;
Conf. De Confusione Linguarum;
Congr. De Congressu Eruditionis Gratia;
Cont. De Vita Contemplativa;
Decal. De Decalogo;
Det. Quod Deterius Potiori Insidiari Soleat;
Deus. Quod Deus Sit Immutabilis;
Ebr. De Ebrietate;
Flac. In Flaccum;
Fug. De Fuga et Inventione;
Gig. De Gigantibus;
Her. Quis Rerum Divinarum Heres Sit;
Hypoth. Hypothetica;
Jos. De Josepho;
LA  Legum Allegoriarum;
Legat. Legatio ad Gaium;
Mig. De Migratione Abrahami;
Mut. De Mutatione Nominum;
Op. De Opificio Mundi;
Plant. De Plantatione;
Post. De Posteritate Caini;
Praem. De Praemiis et Poenis;
Prob. Quod Omnis Probus Liber Sit;
Prov. De Providentia;
QE  Quaestiones et Solutiones in Exodum;
QG  Quaestiones et Solutiones in Genesim;
Sacr. De Sacrificiis Abelis et Caini;
Sobr. De Sobrietate;
Somn. De Somniis;
Spec. leg. De Specialibus Legibus;
Virt. De Virtutibus.

13. Editions of Philo’s works and their translations

The Greek texts of Philo’s works:

• Philonis Judaei Opera Omnia. Textus editus ad fidem optimarum editionum. (Lipsiae: Sumptibus E.B.  Schwickerti, 1828-1829), Vol. 1-6.
• Philonis Alexandrini Opera Quae Supersunt. Ediderunt Leopoldus Cohn et Paulus Wendland (Berolini: Typis et impensis Georgii Reimeri/ Walther de Gruyter & Co., MDCCCLXXXXVI – MCMXXX, reprinted in 1962). Vols. 1-7.

The Armenian text and its English translation:

• A. Terian, Philonis Alexandrini De Animalibus: The Armenian Text with an Introduction, Translation, and Commentary. Studies in Hellenistic Judaism, Supplements to Studia Philonica 1. (Chico: Scholars Press, 1981).

Translations of complete works:

• The Works of Philo. Complete and Unabridged. Translated by Charles Duke Yonge, New Updated Edition. (Hedrickson Publishers, 1995).
• F. H. Colson and G. H. Whitaker, eds., The Works of Philo (Cambridge, Mass: Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press; London: William Heinemann, 1929-1953), Vols. 1-10. Ralph Marcus, ed, Vols 10-12, containing works of Philo available only in Armenian.

Selections of works of Philo in translation:

• Philo, Selections ed., Hans Lewy in Three Jewish Philosophers (Cleveland, New York, Philadelphia, 1961).
• Philo of Alexandria, The Contemplative Life, The Giants, and Selections. Translation and Introduction by David Winston. Preface by John Dillon. (New York/ Ramsey/Toronto: Paulist Press, 1981).
• Ronald  Williamson, Jews in the Hellenistic World: Philo (Cambridge: Cambridge
  University Press, 1989).

14. Major Works on Philo

• T. H. Billings, The Platonism of Philo Judaeus (Chicago, 1919).
• H. A. Wolfson, Philo (Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press, 1947), Vols 1-2.
• C. H. Dodd, The Interpretation of the Fourth Gospel (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1963).
• Ronald Williamson, Philo and the Epistle to the Hebrews (Leiden: E. J. Brill, 1970).
• R. C. Baer, Philo’s Use of the Categories Male and Female (Leiden: E. J. Brill, 1970).
• S. Sandmel, Philo of Alexandria: An Introduction (New York/Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1979).
• Harold W. Attridge, The Epistle to the Hebrews (Hermeneia; Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1989).
• Dorothy Sly, Philo’s Perception of Women (Atlanta: Scholars Press, 1990).
• Ross Shepard Kraemer, Her Share of the Blessings: Women’s religions among Pagans, Jews, and Christians in the Greco-Roman World (NewYork /Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1992).
• John M. Dillon, The Middle Platonists (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1977, 1996).

Author Information

Marian Hillar
Email: hillar@sbcglobal.net
Center for Philosophy and Socinian Studies

U. S. A.