Being

From virtually the beginning of the Western tradition, philosophers have at least sporadically recognized that being is the primordial issue in philosophy. It is such because every theoretical sentence is implicitly or explicitly governed by a theoretical operator including a conjugated form of the verb “to be,” hence, everything we think or talk about is either being itself or an instance or aspect of being. In the language of concepts, the concept being presupposes no other concepts, but is itself presupposed by all other concepts. According to the Eleatic Visitor in Plato’s Sophist, being [ousia] was of sufficient philosophical importance to his prede­cessors to have instigated “something like a battle of gods and giants among them.” Shortly thereafter, being qua being [to on he on] (or, more accurately, the entity as entity, or better yet, the be-er as be-er) is identified in Aristotle’s Metaphysics—among the most influential books in the history of philosophy—as the issue at the heart of first philosophy. Nevertheless, there are central issues concerning being that are not recognized by any Greek philosopher, indeed not identified until the thirteenth century C.E., in some works by Thomas Aquinas. But these issues are not adequately treated by Aquinas, and, after Aquinas, they are recognized only quite rarely.

This article presents these issues about being by relying upon the present-continuous tense of English, as used in the sentence “It’s being” and the sentence operator “It’s being such that.” These formulations make possible the articulation of the primordiality, universality, and uniqueness of being. More specifically, this article presents the issues through the lens of the structural-systematic philosophy (SSP); the issues’ importance is indicated by the explicit inclusion of the word “being” in, say, the titles of the books Structure and Being, Being and God, and Being and Nothing.

Table of Contents

1. Articulating Being
   1. Refinements of Vocabulary
   2. A Refinement of Semantically Significant Sentence-Structures
2. Theories of Being and Theories of Be-ers
3. Central Aspects of the SSP’s Theory of Being: The Primordiality, Ubiquity, Uniqueness, and Universal Intelligibility of Being
4. Being and Whatness
5. Neglectfulness of Being
   1. Examples of Neglectfulness of Being
      1. Paired Philosophical Examples
      2. An Additional Philosophical Example
      3. An Example from Physics
6. Being and Existing
7. Dimensions of Being
8. Being and God
   1. The Relation between the Contingent Dimension of Being and the Absolutely Necessary Dimension of Being
   2. God
   3. The Principle of Rank within Being and Evolution
   4. The SSP and Christianity
9. References and Further Reading

1. Articulating Being

One centrally important reason for lack of sufficient clarity in philo­sophical treatments of being is that at least most of the ordinary languages that philosophers have relied on throughout the history of philosophy, emphatically including English, articulate being in a variety of inadequate ways. That they do so adds needless and often misleading complications to being’s articulation. A first source of complications in ordinary English is the vocabulary available for the articulation of being; a second source is the structures of the sentences it provides for articulating being. Each of the following two subsections first identifies specific problems with ordinary-English ways of articulating being, and then introduces refine­ments to the SSP’s language that enables it to avoid these problems. This article’s version of the SSP differs from Lorenz B. Puntel’s version, particularly in the ways it articulates being and hence in its theory of being.

a. Refinements of Vocabulary

 Three peculiarities of the words used by ordinary English to artic­ulate being are of particular importance as far as philosophical articulations of being are concerned. The first peculiarity is that the word “being” has (most relevantly) the following distinct senses: (1) a nominal sense, in which “being” is roughly synonymous with “entity,” and (2) a verbal sense, in which “being” is roughly synonymous with “existing,” in the sense articulated in the Oxford English Dictionary (henceforth, OED) as “the fact of belonging to the universe of things material or immaterial.” Because the two senses are available, one can say both “To be is to be a being” and “To be is to be being,” or “I am a being” and “I am being.” Philosophical uses of the word “being” that do not clearly distinguish these senses, or that do not make clear, in all relevant cases, which sense is intended, require clarification.

The second important peculiarity of words used in ordinary English to articulate being is that, because the word “is” is so often used as copula (or, on an alternative interpretation, as a component of predicates, as in “is red” or “is human”), such sentences as “Fred is” can appear to be incomplete; hearing the sentence “Fred is,” one might well wonder, “Fred is what?”. Similarly, the question “Does God exist?” is more readily intelligible than is the question, “Is God?”.

Presumably because sentences ending with “is” so easily appear incom­plete, the use of “is” as the final word in sentences situating the referents of their subject terms within being are rarely used. Instead, for this sense, the “is” usually follows the word “there,” in the phrase “there is.” In this phrase (as in “there are”), the “there” does not perform its usual role of indicating a location that is specified later in the sentence (as in, “There is a pizza restaurant on the corner”). It instead signals that the “is” situates the referent of its subject term within being, rather than functioning as copulative or predicative. That English can express this sense of being by “is,” by “exists,” and by “there is,” with the first of these being the most problematic, introduces avoidable confusion.

The third important peculiarity in ordinary-English words used to articulate being is that several conjugated forms of the verb “to be” have roots different both from that of the infinitive and from those of one another; these include, among others, “am, “is,” and “are.” Consequently, although any sentence using any one of these words at least co-artic­ulates being, the words themselves do not make that fully explicit.

One way to improve talk about being, using a slightly modified version of ordinary English, is to introduce a capitalized version of the word (as is done in Being and God and Being and Nothing), and to explicitly link that version to the use of “being” in sentences that situate the referents of their subject terms within being. That remedy, however, avoids only the first of the three peculiarities just identi­fied. Therefore, this article, following White’s Toward a Philosophical Theory of Being (henceforth, TAPTOE) and “Rearticulating Being,” proceeds differently. First, instead of using the word “being” in a nominal sense, in which it would be roughly synonymous with the word “entity,” it introduces for that sense the technical term “be-er,” a word similar to such ordinary-language terms as “runner,” “swimmer,” “writer,” and “philosopher.” Just as running is not a runner and does not run, being is not a be-er and does not be; instead, runners run, and be-ers be. Second, the SSP often uses “be” when ordinary English would require “am,” “is,” or “are,” that is, as the sole form of its verb “to be” in the simple present, and as a component of present-continuous verbs. A native speaker of Jamaican English has confirmed to me that that language indeed uses the sentence “We be jamming,” and that sentence is intelligible to speakers of other versions of English, as are (for example) “I be talking,” “You be reading,” and “We be philosophizing.” In the technical language of the SSP, there be human be-ers; human be-ers be the be-ers that be human. Their unavoidable mode of being be being human.

Grammatically, these variants of parts of the verb “to be” make that verb much more regular than its counterpart in ordinary English. Philosophically, they enable the SSP to directly and explicitly articulate being and its ubiquity. Thereby, it is hoped, this modified, technical English presents a more powerful obstacle than does ordinary English to the tendency that Heidegger calls forgetfulness or oblivion of being. In other words, these changes are meant to make it harder for us to fail to notice the ubiquity of being—to notice that whenever we are speaking or thinking, we are speaking or thinking either (rarely) of being itself, or (usually) of instances or aspects of being.

b. A Refinement of Semantically Significant Sentence-Structures

Drawing on several works by Étienne Gilson, this subsection shows how the vocabulary introduced above can make possible the direct and explicit articulation of being. Such articulation is the strongest obstacle to the oblivion of being (of which more below) only if it is accompanied by a refinement of semantically significant sentence-structures. A first step is taken with clarification of the ubiquity of being as articulable in theories.

Theories are articulated as collections of indicative sentences and, as Gilson 1952 (197) points out (using the term “affirmations” rather “indicative sentences”),

the principal function of the verb is to affirm, and since affir­mation remains the same whatever may happen to be affirmed, a single verb should suffice for all affirmations. In point of fact, there is such a verb, and it is “to be.” If only spoken usage allowed it, we would never use any other one…. Not I live, or I sit, but I am living, I am sitting and likewise in all other cases.

If the “ams” in “am living” and “am sitting” are understood as components of present-continuous verbs rather than as being copulative or predicative uses of “am,” then of course they are not simply forms of the verb “to be,” but even then, the present-continuous verbs that include them co-articulate being. Moreover, additional distinctions are necessary, for example between the likes of “She be running” and “She be a runner” or, more expansively, “She be a be-er who also (more specifically) be running (right now)” and “She be a be-er who also (more specifically) be a runner (even if not running right now).”

A consequence of the possibility of such reformulations is that every theoretical sentence can be made to co-articulate being. Yet, for reasons given in Gilson 1948 (284-5), co-articulation of being has not sufficed, historically, to counter the oblivion of being. One reason for this is that the sentences considered in that text, like most sentences in English and in most and perhaps all other languages that have been used by philoso­phers, include semantically significant grammatical subjects.

According to Gilson, being is most directly articulated in sentences of the form “S [a semantically significant subject] be”; any such sentence articulates “the composition of the subject with its act of being, it unites them in thought as they are already united in reality.” [original text altered slightly to incorporate this article’s language of being]. Yet although any such sentence unites them, the text tells us that the human intellect (284) tends to focus on the subject—the be-er—and thereby to neglect the “act of being.” In any such sentence, being is articulated only “as included in the [be-er].” That it is only so articulated:

is often serious, to the point of sometimes being catastrophic, because, as history has made us see, the spontaneous conceptu­alism of ordinary thought tends constantly to reinforce the essence of the [be-er] to the detriment of its act of [being]. Let us also add that this fact is easily explained because the [be-er] has more than its [being], that is, it has its concept… Gilson 1948 284-5.

Gilson 1948 recognizes, as the only sentence-forms that articulate being, “S is p” and “S is.” The SSP, however, links its semantics and ontology not to sentence-forms including semantically significant subject-terms, but instead to sentences of the form “It’s such-and-suching.” This form makes it easy to explicitly and exclusively articulate being itself, not being as included in any be-er. This is done with the sentences “It’s being” and “It be being”, whose only semantically significant terms are their present-continuous verbs (the “It” in such sentences is considered below). The decisive contributions that these formulations make to the SSP’s theory of being are explained in greater detail in what follows, but one that links to (Gilson 1948) is appropriately included here. According to that text (248), if a sentence of the form “S is” is understood as articulating being, it says “not that the subject is itself, which is always true of everything, but [instead] that it is, which is not true, and moreover not always, except for some.”

As is more fully explained in what follows, the SSP’s sentence “It be being” is always true; this is a first indication of the primordiality of being.

2. Theories of Being and Theories of Be-ers

Throughout the history of philosophy, most theories that theoretical frameworks relying on ordinary English would classify as theories of being are, according to the SSP, instead theories of be-ers. Moreover, in this terminology (and, more broadly, in that of the SSP), theories of be-ers are ontologies. Theories of be-ers are concisely summarized by sentences of the form “To be a be-er is to be x,” with x generally replaced by one or more nouns, with appropriate article(s). Most ontologies, both historically and at present, hold that to be a be-er is to be either a thing (or object or substance), or an attribute of a thing (a property or, in some variants, a relation); according to such ontologies, the apple that is red and is on the table is (or be), as does the redness of that apple, and the table that the apple is on. The SSP’s ontology holds instead, as discussed in various contexts in TAPTOE, that to be a be-er is to be a fact (or, in TAPTOE’s technical term, a facting).

Why is there need for a theory of being? To answer this question, compare running: one could assemble a list of runners, but unless one had a theory of running, one would be unable to explain why the list contained the items that it did. Similarly, the one thing that all be-ers have in common is that they be, so in the absence of a theory of being, one is unable to explain why the list of be-ers contains the items that it does.

In what follows, clarity is served by speaking of frameworks for theories of be-ers that include thing- or substance- or object-ontologies as whatness-frameworks, because at least the most prominent members of that family of frameworks include identifiable versions of the thesis of the primacy of whatness, that is, the thesis that every be-er is, primarily, its whatness. In Aristotelian frameworks, the problem of being is not recognized, so the primacy of whatness is the primacy of substance over at least accidental attributes; according to such frameworks, Alan White is, primarily, either a human be-er (essence) or the specific human be-er that he is (individual), but he must be that whatness in order to be, at some specific time, doing anything else, for example, sitting rather than standing.

Far later than Aristotle, Thomas Aquinas takes an important step in recognizing, at least occasionally, the primacy of being over whatness but, as Gilson 2002 indicates (163), he has important predecessors:

Other philosophers had preceded Thomas along this path, and all of them helped him to follow it through to the end, particularly those among them who clearly raised the problem of [being]. Alfarabi, Algazel, Avicenna among the Arabs, Moses Maimonides among the Jews, had already noted the truly exceptional position that [being] occupies in relation to essence…. What seems to have especially intrigued these philosophers is that, however far you push the analysis of essence, [being] must be added to it in some way from outside, as an extrinsic determination conferring on it the act of [being]…. These philosophers started from essence, and using analysis they sought to discover [being] within it, but they could not find it there. Hence their conclusion: [being] was extra­neous to essence as such…. So Alfarabi concludes: “[Being] is not a constitutive factor; it is only an accessory accident.”

As this passage makes clear, these predecessors move beyond Aristotle in positing the primacy of whatness not only over attributes, but also over being. Yet if what is called being is extraneous to essence, then essence is extraneous to what is called being. If, however, essence is, and is extraneous to what is called being, then what is called being is not being in its ubiquity. Additional steps must be taken.

As indicated above and considered in somewhat more detail below, some of those steps are detectable in various works by Thomas Aquinas although, as shown in Being and God (1.3.2), those works contain no theory of being. Moreover, those works’ articulations of being have not been widely influential. Indeed, as noted in Gilson 1952 (118), “the genuine meaning of the Thomistic notion of being is, around 1729, completely and absolutely forgotten,” thanks chiefly to the dominant influence of Suarez. A revival of so-called existential Thomism develops in the 1930s, and is sufficiently developed by the 1950s that Clarke 1955 includes (61-2) the following announcement:

What is now widely known as the existential interpretation of Thomistic metaphysics has definitely come of age. (By existential I mean that interpretation which sees in the act of [being] the source of all perfection and intelligibility, hence the center of gravity of St. Thomas’[s] whole philosophy)…. As speculation and text work proceed hand in hand, each illumi­nating the other, it is becoming more and more evident that this perspective is by no means some short-lived fad borrowed from the contemporary Existentialist movements and superimposed extrinsically on St. Thomas’[s] own thought, but rather that it is that one luminous center … in the light of which alone the total body of St. Thomas’[s] texts takes on full intelligibility and coherence.

Fad or not, the revival appears to have been relatively short-­lived, and certainly had no influence on the mainstream analytic philosophy that has been dominant since around the time of the revival. Worse yet, as the SSP shows, “the total body of St. Thomas’[s] texts” cannot “[take] on full intelligibility and coherence,” not only because the heart of the substance ontology relied on by those texts is unintelligible (see TAPTOE 2.5), but also—and more importantly, for this article—because although some of those texts recognize the primacy of being, none adequately articulates the ubiquity of being because in them, essence remains somehow distinct from being (see also Being and God 1.3.2.2). The remainder of this section, however, focuses on semantic and ontological problems that would remain even if a variant were developed according to which essence was fully intrinsic to being.

The semantic and ontological problems endemic to Thomistic being-frameworks are linked to the one identified in a passage from Gilson 1948 considered above. They arise from the at least tacit reliance of Thomistic frameworks on compositional semantics—according to which, roughly speaking, the meanings or semantic values of sentences are functions of the meanings or semantic values of their sub-sentential components—and on ontologies strongly linked to semantically significant grammatical subjects and predicates. Within these frameworks, the semantic counterparts to both subjects and predicates are concepts, such that, for example, the sentence “Unicorns are mythological” links the word “unicorns” to the concept unicorn and the word “mythological” to the concept mythological. The semantic status of being, within such frameworks, is problematic because there is no concept that can be linked to the word “is” (or “are”) in any manner comparable to that in which the concept unicorn is linked to the word “unicorn,” and the concept mythological to the word “mythological.” This makes both the semantic and the ontological status of being obscure.

This point is worth emphasizing. Asked to clarify “unicorns,” the utterer of the sentence would easily be able to say that unicorns are animals that are like horses except that they have single sharp horns growing from their foreheads, and asked about “mythological,” the utterer could easily say that “mythological” beings are ones that occur only in stories told by human be-ers but not, unlike for example horses, cats, and dogs, in reality. But asked about the “are,” the utterer would have no comparably available explanation.

Gilson 2002 (172) addresses this problem by noting initially that “Being is the first of all concepts,” because being is co-articulated in every sentence of the form ‘S is’ or ‘S is p’ and, as shown above, any indicative sentence can be rewritten into a sentence with such a form. Being is also, however, “the most universal and abstract [concept], the richest in extension and the poorest in comprehension.” It is “richest in extension” because any be-er can be articulated in a sentence whose verb is “is,” but “poorest in comprehension” because sentences of the form “S is” can appear to say nothing specific about the be-er. Because of this poorness in comprehension, Gilson 2002 voices the suspicion that we would need either “an intuition of [being]” or an “intellectual intuition of being as being” in order to comprehend it, yet such an intuition would be inarticulable and thus would not make being conceivable. “But,” the book continues (174), “reason dislikes what is inconceivable, and because this is true of [being], philosophy does all it can do to avoid it.”

Concerning the articulation of being, then, Thomistic frameworks face first the at least partially avoidable problem that, because their sentences at best co-articulate being, they tend to place more emphasis on be-ers than on being. This problem is avoided by those who emphasize being, but those who do, even if they also were to recognize the ubiquity of being, would face the insuperable obstacles to clarification of being posed by those frameworks’ semantics and ontologies. What is needed, then, if philosophy is to cease to avoid being, is not a new Thomistic theory of being, but instead a different theory of being.

3. Central Aspects of the SSP’s Theory of Being: The Primordiality, Ubiquity, Uniqueness, and Universal Intelligibility of Being

Given that a theory of being (or of anything else) must be a collection of meaningful, or semantically significant, sentences, any adequate theory of being must explain its semantics, that is, how its sentences are meaningful.

As indicated in various contexts in TAPTOE, the SSP rejects both compositional semantics and any ontology or semantics strongly linked to the structural components of subject-predicate sentences. It links its ontology and semantics instead to sentences with the structure “It’s such-and-suching.” Because such sentences—techni­cally, sentencings—have no semantically significant subsentential components, their semantics cannot be compositional; they are instead contextual, that is, ones according to which words have determinate meanings or semantic values only within the contexts of sentences. The semantic contents of sentences are propositions (technically, propositionings), and these semantic contents relate to the SSP’s ontology such that every propositioning is identical to a facting. The absolutely comprehensive facting IT’S BEING (or IT BE BEING) is identical to the true propositioning It’s being (or It be being), which is expressible by the true sentencing “It’s being” (or “It be being”).

Being as articulated in the sentence “It be being” may appear to be, in Gilson 2002’s terms, “universal and abstract,” but it is straightforwardly and transparently concretized by means of that sentence’s expansion into the operator “It be being such that,” which can govern any and every sentencing that expresses a propositioning. An example: “It be being such that It be Alan Whiting such that It be revising It’s TAPTOEing,” a sentencing true at the time of its initial compo­sition. Hence, although being is of problematic intelligibility within the theoretical frameworks considered and relied on in Gilson’s works, because their semantic focus is on concepts and being has no clear conceptual status within them, within the framework of the SSP, being is directly articulated by a true sentencing that expresses a true propositioning identical to an actual facting.

The uniqueness of being mentioned in this subsection’s title is clarified by more detailed comparison of being with running (running being simply one of a vast number of possible comparative items). Most human be-ers are capable of running or (in slightly different terms) have the capacity to run. The human be-er who runs is activating that capacity—that human be-er be at work running, be engaged in running—whereas the human be-er who sits generally retains the capacity to run while not activating it, while not engaged in running. In contrast, every human be-er who actually be cannot avoid engaging in being, cannot avoid being at work being; any human be-er not engaging in being would be a merely possible human be-er, like a future grandchild or perhaps a human be-er who, although having been, be no longer. Thus, whereas running is an ontological capacity because human be-ers (along with be-ers of many other kinds) can but need not be engaged in running, being is not a capacity, because be-ers, of whatsoever sort, have any capacities, activated or not, only if and when they be. This, then, is the most central way that the being of be-ers differs from all of their other engagements (or, more accurately, modes of being): being is the engagement or being-at-­work (or, again, mode of being) that is not an ontological capacity. In this way, it is absolutely unique.

The uniqueness of being among the engagements of be-ers is further illuminated by the phenomenon of cryopreservation. Some organisms—including human embryos and adult members of a few species of vertebrates (chiefly amphibians)—can continue to be—and to be the organisms that they are—while they are frozen. While they are frozen, all of their metabolic processes cease. Hence, when frozen, they do not activate their capacities for aging or even for living, in anything like the usual sense of living, although they are not dead. They are not dead because they retain the capacity to live; that capacity is reactivated when they cease to be frozen. Even as frozen, then, they continue to be, to engage in being.

An additional step leads, in a manner different from those introduced above, from the being of be-ers to being itself. No organism has the capacity to bring itself into being, because before the organism is, the organism has no capacities. And yet, the coming into being of the organism reveals that it was possible that the organism come into being. The coming into being of the organism therefore reveals the capacity of being to be manifest, to manifest itself, as that organism. The birth of the organism is being’s reconfiguration of itself so as to include that organism; it is the emergence of the organism into and hence within being. For this reason, the gestation of the organism that grows into a salamander is also articulable as being engaging in salamandering: It be being such that It be salamandering.

“Salamandering” is of course a peculiar word, but one whose inclusion in this article should not be surprising, given that one way to be, according to the SSP’s ontology, is to be an actual facting identical to a true propositioning expressible by a true sentencing such as, for example, “It’s salamandering.” A fuller consideration of the “It” in this sentencing further clarifies the involvement of being in salaman­dering (on this topic, see also Being and God 3.2.1.1).

According to the OED, the “it” of “It’s raining” (and that of “It’s salamandering”) is “the subject of an imper­sonal verb or impersonal statement, expressing action or a condition of things simply, without reference to any agent.” The OED includes the following examples: “It has fared badly with the soldiers; How is it in the city? It will soon come to a rupture between them; It is all over with poor Jack; It is very pleasant here.” Resituated within the theoretical framework of the SSP, none of these sentences can articulate any condition of things, but each can articulate, intelligibly and coherently, a configuration of being. That each can indeed do so is revealed by the fact that each remains intelligible—although, of course, also becomes peculiar—if its “it” is replaced with “being”: “Being has fared badly with the soldiers; How is being in the city? Being will soon come to a rupture between them; Being is all over with poor Jack; Being is very pleasant here.” Given its rejection of the semantics linked to subject-predicate sentences, the SSP cannot of course identify being, in any of these cases, as the referent of the “it” that the word “being” replaces. Instead, it takes each “it” to indicate being, a configuration of which is articulated by the words that complete the sentence. Hence, an alternative formulation of one of the sentences introduced above is, “It’s being such that It’s faring badly with the soldiers.”

A further step is taken following the introduction of a second instance of the impersonal “it,” one that is of central importance to the SSP. This is the “it” of the theoretical operator, which has the forms “It is (it be) the case that” and “It is (it be) true that.” As explained more fully in TAPTOE (see 3.4-5, 6.3, and 6.3.1.), prefixing the theoretical operator to any indicative (hence, theoretical) sentence can make explicit the semantic status of that sentence. Hence, for example, the semantic status of “It’s raining,” as asserted, is explicitly articulated in the sentence “It is the case that it’s raining.”

In terms of indicative function, the “it” of any sentencing, such as “It’s raining,” and the “it” of the theoretical operator are not simply identical. The “it” of “It’s raining” usually indicates a configuration of being at a specific spatio-temporal location. Because, however, the theoretical operator makes explicit the semantic status of every theoretical sentence, its scope is absolutely unrestricted: it thus indicates being as a whole. The example sentence is thus understood as follows: being as a whole is configured such that being here-and-now is configured such that raining is ongoing. Or: It be being as a whole such that It be being here-and-now such that It be raining. Or: It be being as a whole such that It always be being such that It be 2+2=4ing.

In closing this section, note that a thesis central to the SSP’s theory of being as such is that being is universally intelligible.

4. Being and Whatness

A central advantage of being-frameworks (over essence- or whatness-frameworks) is that they can make the essence or whatness of any be-er intrinsic to the being of that be-er. By contrast, even in whatness-frameworks that recognize being, being is generally taken to be extrinsic to essence or whatness. This section shows that and how, according to the SSP, (1) being is prior to the whatness of any be-er and (2) whatness is intrinsic to the being of any be-er. To this end, this article, following TAPTOE, introduces two examples, one of a biological be-er’s coming- and ceasing-to-be, and one of an artifactual be-er’s coming- and ceasing-to-be.

The biological example is a possible case of in-vitro fertili­zation (in-vitro so as not to add a woman’s womb as a complicating factor). Prior to fertilization, there are, of central importance to this example, two be-ers, thus, two be-ers that be, that be engaged in being: these be a sperm cell and an egg cell. If fertilization occurs, egg and sperm will have ceased to be, and a zygote will have come to be. Much about specifically what that zygote will be, if it comes to be, is presumably determined by the genetic make-ups of the sperm and egg cells. If a zygote comes to be, it may be the only zygote that could have come to be, in this situation, but it will be that zygote only when it comes to be. There be one cell at work being a sperm cell, and one cell at work being an egg cell; if fertilization occurs, it will be because egg and sperm have jointly reconfigured themselves into constituents of a new be-er, the zygote.

Considered somewhat differently: sperm and egg are both specific configurations of being, of being because they be, and specific because each has specific capacities, and lacks capacities had by other kinds of be-ers; each has the capacity to be for some time, to unite with the other, and, in so uniting, to be reconfigured, or to reconfigure itself, such that some of what had been its constituents become constituents of a zygote. They lack the capacity to be jointly reconfigured, or to jointly reconfigure themselves, into anything other than a zygote. If they unite, the zygote will come to be as itself a specific or restricted configuration of being.

Even if the zygote as a new organism comes to be, it will not, of course, continue forever to be. At some point, it will die—possibly quite abruptly. The physical changes in the organism, when it dies, can appear to be relatively slight, but the ontological change could not be more profound. Following death, many organs that had been components of the organism’s body may continue to be, and to be at work continuing to be, for some time, but they will no longer be at work as organs, because there will no longer be an organism.

The artifactual example is the following: contemplating what to cook for breakfast, I may narrow my choices to oatmeal or an omelet. If I choose to make the omelet, I have—in one terminology—determined the essence of the be-er that will come to be if I succeed in making it. I can have before me all of the ingredients I will use—eggs and, say, sausage, onion, cheese, and the butter with which I will coat the frying pan—and if I proceed, what omelet will come to be, if an omelet comes to be, is highly determinate. But there is not yet an omelet, and nothing about the possible omelet’s essence or whatness determines whether or not it will come to be. What have come to be, already, are the ingredients, with their constituents jointly at work enabling them to continue to be, and I myself, the potential chef. If I opt for the omelet rather than for oatmeal, and if I successfully follow the requisite procedures, the ingredients will begin to work together in such a way that, soon thereafter, an omelet will begin to be. But the beginning to be is the beginning of the omelet—there be no omelet until the omelet be; until the omelet be, the ingredients be, but the omelet does not. After I have eaten the omelet, of course, the omelet no longer be, but its constituents continue to be, as they—or at least some of them—are reconfigured, temporarily, into constituents of my body.

5. Neglectfulness of Being

This subsection is metasystematic because it treats texts external to the SSP, but it  is included to further clarify the central importance of being as a topic for systematic philosophy. Its phrase “neglectfulness of being” is a formulation more accurate than the Heideggerian “forgetfulness” or “oblivion” of being, mentioned above. The reason for introducing this phrase is suggested by what is said in subsection 3 about the theoretical operator. Because the theoretical operator indicates and indeed discloses being as a whole, being cannot be wholly absent from any theoretical framework. In many—indeed, presumably, in the overwhelming majority—it is tacitly presupposed, and nowhere denied. This is generally wholly non-problematic, although it would be a fatal flaw in any systematic philosophy, because any systematic philosophy not including a theory of being would be incomplete. Also fatally flawed, however, are theories that appear to deny being, despite (unavoidably) presupposing being. This is clarified by examples.

a. Examples of Neglectfulness of Being

i. Paired Philosophical Examples

van Inwagen 1996 includes (96) the following:

If the notion of an abstract object makes sense at all, it seems evident that if everything were an abstract object, if the only objects were abstract objects, there is an obvious and perfectly good sense in which there would be nothing at all, for there would be no physical things, no stuffs, no events, no space, no time, no Cartesian egos, no God…. When people want to know why there is anything at all, they want to know why that bleak state of affairs does not obtain.

Worth noting in passing is that speaking of states of affairs as “obtaining” or not “obtaining” —rather than as being or not being—is common in analytic philosophy, and is an evasion or neglect of being; what other than being could “obtaining” be? Be that as it may, by “there would be nothing at all,” van Inwagen 1996 explicitly means that there would be no non-abstract objects; there would however be, in his scenario, abstract objects, hence not the utter absence of being, which, as shown below, cannot be.

Lowe 1996, in response to van Inwagen 1996, includes (115) the following:

Suppose we could show that there couldn’t be a world containing only abstract objects, perhaps by arguing that abstract objects necessarily depend for their existence upon concrete objects: what would follow? Clearly, it would follow that van Inwagen’s ‘bleak’ state of affairs couldn’t obtain. And yet, in a perfectly clear sense, this wouldn’t suffice to show that it was necessary for something concrete to exist: for we wouldn’t have foreclosed the possibility that nothing at all—nothing either concrete or abstract—might have existed. To foreclose that possibility, it seems, we would need also to show that at least some objects, abstract or concrete, exist in every possible world.

For Lowe 1996, the possibility that “nothing at all—nothing either concrete or abstract—might have existed” is open if there is a possible world containing no concrete or abstract objects (see 111-12). That possible world would however have to be a possible world that would not only itself be but would be distinct from other possible worlds, including the actual world. It would, that is, be situated within being, and would not be—impossibly—the utter absence of being.

ii. An Additional Philosophical Example

Other works by Peter van Inwagen are among the relatively few by analytic philosophers that recognize that there even might be a significant distinction between what the SSP terms being and be-ers, and hence a need for theories of being. van Inwagen 2008b includes (278) a conver­sation in which a fictional Alice argues that “being is a feature of everything,” asking, “who could deny that everything there is is?”. The conversation leads to “the identification of being with self-identity” (287). The text recognizes as a possible alternative—attributed to Sartre, among unnamed others—that being is “an activity that things engage in, the most general activity that they engage in.” van Inwagen 2009’s treatment of this alternative includes (477) the following (quoted in part in Being and God, 196):

If there is a most general activity that a human be-er (or anything else that engages in activities) engages in—presumably it would be something like ‘living’ or ‘getting older’ [the phenomenon of cryopreservation, introduced above, reveals that this is not the case]—it is simply wrong to call it ‘being’. And it is equally wrong to apply to it any word containing a root related to ‘être’ or ‘esse’ or ‘existere’ or ‘to on’ or ‘einai’ or ‘Sein’ or ‘be’ or ‘am’ or ‘is.’ One cannot, of course, engage in this most general activity (supposing there to be such an activity) unless one is, but this obvious truth is simply a conse­quence of the fact that one can’t engage in any activity unless one is: if an activity is being engaged in, there has to be something to engage in it.

As Being and God notes, this passage fails to clarify or even to recognize being because it makes no attempt to explain the “is” of “unless one is,” or the “be” of “there has to be something.” According to the SSP, if one actually is, then one be being, and actually to be something is to be being something.

Perhaps also worth noting is that van Inwagen 2009 attempts to show that being is somehow superfluous or avoidable by introducing (478) a fictional Martian language with the following characteristics:

There are in Martian no substantives in any way semantically related to ‘être’ or ‘esse’ or ‘existere’ or ‘to on’ or ‘einai’ or ‘Sein’ or ‘be’ or ‘am’ or ‘is.’ (In particular, Martian lacks the nouns ‘being and ‘existence’….) There is, moreover, no such verb in Martian as ‘to exist’ and no adjectives like ‘existent’ or ‘extant’. Finally, the Martians do not even have the phrases ‘there is and ‘there are’.

van Inwagen’s Martian language does, however, include the following sentences (478-79, emphases added):

Everything is not a dragon.

It is not the case that everything is not (a) God.

I think, therefore not everything is not I.

It makes me strangely uneasy to contemplate the fact that it might have been the case that everything was not always I.

It makes me strangely uneasy to contemplate the fact that every­thing is not (identical with) anything.

It is a great mystery why it is not the case that everything is not (identical with) anything.

As the italicizations clearly show, each of these sentences includes a form of the verb “to be.” Being is thus neither superfluous nor avoided in Martian, and it would be open to Martian philosophers to introduce counterparts to “being,” “be-er,” “It be being,” and “It be being such that” into their philosophical languages.

iii. An Example from Physics

A Universe from Nothing (Krauss 2012) presents itself (xiii) as responding to the question “Why is there something rather than nothing?” That it exhibits neglectfulness of being is evident from its assertion (xiv) that “‘nothing’ is every bit as physical as ‘something,’ especially if it is to be defined as the ‘absence of something.’” Any “nothing” that is physical is not, obviously, utter non-being. Nevertheless, additional details are worth noting.

According to Kraus’s 2012 (xvii), “perhaps the most surprising discovery in physics in the past century … has produced remarkable new support for the idea that our universe arose from precisely nothing,” The text later (58) clarifies “precisely nothing” as follows: “By nothing, I do not mean nothing, but rather nothing—in this case, the nothingness of what we normally call empty space.” Yet later (98), this “precisely nothing” is supplemented by several other factors, and becomes “essentially nothing”: “if inflation indeed is responsible for all the small fluctuations in the density of matter and radiation that would later result in the gravitational collapse of matter into galaxies and stars and planets and people, then it can be truly said that we are all here today because of quantum fluctuations in what is essentially nothing.” This passage clearly presupposes that matter, radiation, and quantum fluctuations be. Moreover, what is first described as empty space is later (104) said to be endowed with energy. As so endowed, it is “Nothing,” and (152) it “can effectively create everything we see, along with an unbelievably large and flat universe.” And yet,

it would be disingenuous to suggest that empty space, which drives inflation, is really nothing. In this picture one must assume that space exists and can store energy, and one uses the laws of physics like general relativity to calculate the consequences. So if we stopped here, one might be justified in claiming that modern science is a long way from really addressing how to get something from nothing. This is just the first step, however. As we expand our understanding, we will next see that inflation can represent simply the tip of a cosmic iceberg of nothingness.

So: a universe “created” by empty space endowed with energy is not a universe from nothing, despite earlier contentions to the contrary, and nothingness as a whole is “a cosmic iceberg.”

Krauss 2012’s cosmic-iceberg sense of nothing/nothingness is (170) “the absence of space and time” but the presence of quantum gravity, and although the text asserts at the outset (xiv) that all of its uses of “nothing” will be “scientific,” the following (174) passage indicates that rather than being required by any scientific theory, these uses are what “work” for the text’s author:

When I have thus far described how something almost always can come from “nothing,” I have focused on either the creation of something from preexisting empty space or the creation of empty space from no space at all. Both initial conditions work for me when I think of the “absence of being” and therefore are possible candidates for nothingness.

The continuation of this passage indicates that neither of these candidates adequately explains the universe as originating from nothing: “I have not addressed directly, however, the issues of what might have existed, if anything, before such creation, what laws governed the creation, or, put more generally, I have not discussed what some may view as the question of First Cause.”

Krauss’ suggested answer to this question is the multiverse (175), although Krauss 2012 nowhere asserts that the multiverse is nothing. Instead, it says (177) that “In a multiverse of any of the types that have been discussed, there could be an infinite number of regions, potentially infinitely big or infinitesimally small, in which there is simply ‘nothing,’ and there could be regions where there is ‘something.’” The empty regions would, of course, be regions. Moreover, Krauss includes the just-quoted contention about regions in which there is “simply ‘nothing’” despite having acknowl­edged (176) that “we don’t currently have a fundamental theory that explains the detailed character of the landscape of a multiverse … (… we generally assume that certain properties, like quantum mechanics, permeate all possibilities…).” In order to permeate all possibilities, the “property” quantum mechanics must of course somehow be.

So, Krauss 2012 in fact does not argue that the universe is created from nothing, even if “create” and “nothing” are understood in the idiosyncratic ways in which the book explains them. Each of its senses of “nothing” is an absence of be-ers of some kinds or other; yet each presupposes being.

6. Being and Existing

“Being and “existing,” and “to be” and “to exist,” are synonymous within some philosophical frameworks. As indicated above, in the SSP’s they are not. In the SSP, existence is the mode of being only of factings within the contingently actual dimension of being (this term is fully explained below). Thus: in the SSP’s terminology, merely possible worlds and the entities within them are (or be), but do not exist.

Some works by Peter van Inwagen follow works of Quine in equating being and existing. The difficulties that ensue, particularly in van Inwagen 2008b, are instructive. The following passage (283) provides a fruitful starting point:

if one says of some woman that she doesn’t exist, one has to be wrong. If the woman in question is “there” to have something said about her, then she exists.

What, one might wonder, if the woman is “there” in a work of fiction? Of Sherlock Holmes, the text asserts (295) the following:

There does exist such a fictional character as Sherlock Holmes. He is as much a part of the World as is any of the short stories and novels in which he “occurs.”

This is problematic at best, because whereas one can buy copies of stories and novels wherein Sherlock Holmes is a character, one cannot acquire the services of Sherlock Holmes; this is an enormous ontological difference. Moreover, van Inwagen 2008b also asserts (111) the following:

Words like ‘dragon’ and ‘unicorn’ are not names for kinds of non-existent things. Rather, they are not names for anything of any sort, for there are no dragons for them to name.

This introduces an inconsistency: if Sherlock Holmes is “as much a part of the World as is any of the short stories and novels in which he ‘occurs,’” then the dragon Smaug is as much a part of the World as is J.R.R. Tolkien’s novel The Hobbit. This inconsistency might plausibly result from a failure to adequately revise, given that the passage about Sherlock Holmes appears in the Coda found only in the third edition of van Inwagen’s Metaphysics, whereas the passage about dragons also appears in the earlier editions. But a comparable inconsistency emerges within the Coda itself. That text denies (296) that “the maps that accompany copies of The Lord of the Rings must be maps of something,” but again, if Sherlock Holmes is a part of what van Inwagen 2008b calls the World because he appears in short stories and novels, then Middle Earth is a part of the World because it appears in novels, and Middle Earth is precisely what the maps accompanying copies of The Lord of the Rings are maps of. One might also ask the following: how could the maps in The Lord of the Rings be maps—rather than mere drawings—if they were not maps of anything?

Distinguishing between being and existing facilitates avoidance of problems of the sorts just identified in van Inwagen 2008b. According to the SSP, Sherlock Holmes, Smaug, and Middle Earth do not exist, but each is (or be), within the non-actual world within which it appears in fictional accounts.

7. Dimensions of Being

Everywhere, there be being, because all be-ers be, or engage in being. But qualification is necessary, because only actual be-ers be; possible but non-actual be-ers do not. This point may also be put as follows: every actual be-er is actively being, is engaged in being. In terms closer to Aristotle’s, to be an actual be-er is to be at work being that be-er. For organisms, as indicated above, to die is to cease to be at work being organisms.

Because possible but non-actual be-ers are not at work being themselves, their mode of being is derivative (see Structure and Being 463, 471). There is, then, no be-er at work being Sherlock Holmes. Sherlock Holmes’s being is derivative in the first instance from the being-at-­work of Arthur Conan Doyle, and in additional instances from the being-at-work of those who read or recall Conan Doyle’s novels and stories, and those who present versions of Sherlock Holmes in films, other works of literature, and so forth, and those who assimilate or recall such versions. A volume of Holmes stories on a library shelf is at work preserving those stories, and it retains the capacity to present them; that capacity is activated when anyone reads the stories.

These modalities of being—contingently actual being (for example, of the volume of Holmes stories) and contingently non-actual being (for example, of Holmes) —require both explanation and supplementation. According to the SSP, there are three distinct modalities of being. Most broadly, there is the absolutely necessary dimension of being and the contingent dimension of being, which can also be termed the dimension of contingent be-ers. The contingent dimension of being includes the dimension of contingently actual be-ers and the dimension of contingently non-actual be-ers. In some other philo­sophical frameworks, the SSP’s dimension of contingently actual be-ers is termed the actual world, and its dimension of contingently non-actual be-ers the realm of merely possible worlds; for conven­ience, this article occasionally uses this terminology.

(To clarify: throughout the discussion that follows, the reader may substitute “propositioning” for “proposition.” The former is a technical term in the SSP’s philosophical language, while the latter is taken from ordinary English. The same holds for “sentencing” and “sentence” and “facting” and “fact.”)

According to the SSP, because modalities qualify or determine true propositions expressible by true sentences, and because true propositions expressible by true sentences are identical to actual facts, modalities qualify actual facts. They are, therefore, being’s own modalities. These modalities of being can be made explicit by means of a number of sentence operators, all of which articulate modalities of being. These operators include the following (with examples of arguments included).

1. 1. It is absolutely necessarily the case that it’s being.

This is considered below.

1. 2. It is contingently actually the case that there are parents.

There currently are parents, but there is no necessity that there be parents: there were no parents shortly after the Big Bang, and the time may come when there are no longer any parents.

1. 3. It is conditionally necessarily the case that every parent has at least one child.

Because it is only contingently actually the case that there are parents, it is not absolutely necessarily the case that every parent has at least one child. Because however to be a parent is to have at least one child, the modality of the relationship is nevertheless one of necessity. Differently put: if it is contingently actually the case that there are parents, then it is necessarily the case that every parent has at least one child.

1. 4. It is contingently non-actually the case that Sherlock Holmes is a detective (or: It is the case in the contingently non-actual worlds presented in various stories, novels, and films that Sherlock Holmes is a detective).
   5. It is necessarily not the case that Fred drew a round square.
   6. It is necessarily not the case that there is nothing (or: that nothing is).

Concerning the dimensions of being, the most important of these sentences are (1) and (6). Both Structure and Being and Being and God include arguments from the truth of versions of (6) to the truth of versions of (1). A variant is the following: By definition, it is possible for any contingent be-er not to be: for each contingent be-er, it is possible that it be, and possible that it not be, so its non-being is possible. Similarly, if contingent being were exhaustive of being—if all being were contingent being—then it would be possible that being not be. But being’s not being would be possible only if it were possible for non-being to be, and that is not possible. Therefore, being is not exhausted by—is not exhaustively—contingent being, and so must include necessary being as well.

Differently put: it would be possible for all being to be contingent being only if either “It be being such that it be absolutely non-being” or “It be being such that it be absolute-nothinging” expressed a proposition, because if either of these sentences expressed a proposition, that proposition would be identical to a fact at least in some possible world, and possibly (at some point) in the actual world. But these sentences, like the sentence “Fred drew a round square,” do not express propositions. According to the SSP, they express pseudo-propositions, and pseudo-propositions are not identical to facts in any world, actual or possible. Such sentences are therefore necessarily false. As indicated in Structure and Being (239n48), the sentence “Fred drew a round square’’ can be analyzed into the sentences “What Fred drew was round” and “What Fred drew was a square.” Each of these sentences expresses a proposition, but the conjunction “What Fred drew was round and was a square,” although grammatically correct, does not.

The sentence “It be being such that it be absolutely non-being” is similar, but somewhat more complicated. Its status is clarified by consideration of the more ordinary-sounding “There is nothing,” understood as expressing the pseudo-proposition There is absolute nothingness or There is absolute non–being. What makes these items pseudo-propositions is the fact that sentences of the form “There is such-and-such’’ express propositions only if the such-and-such somehow is. Any such-and-such, however, that in any way is, is not absolute nothingness, not absolute non-being. But if it is not even possibly the case that there be nothing, then it is absolutely necessarily the case that there be being.

Because there are contingent be-ers, and hence a contingent dimension of being or dimension of contingent be-ers, being is two-dimensional, including both the contingent dimension of being and the absolutely necessary dimension of being. And because it be possible that the entire contingent dimension of being not be, the primacy of being is, more specifically, the primacy of the absolutely necessary dimension of being.

The line of thought developed in the preceding paragraph can be put more technically as follows. The theoretical operator formulable as “It be being the case that,” which (as explained above) implicitly or explicitly governs every indicative sentence that expresses a proposition, and each of its modal variants (“It be being absolutely necessarily the case that,” “It be being contingently actually the case that,” and “It be being contingently not actually the case that”) situates its arguments within being. All propositions or propositionings are arguments of such operators, hence so too are the sentences or sentencings expressing them. Pseudo-propositions, however, are not arguments of these operators, but sentences and sentencings can express pseudo-propositions; those that do are necessarily false. The sentencing “It be being such that it be absolute-nothinging” expresses a pseudo-proposition because the “It be being such that” applicable (in one of its forms) to every sentence and sentencing expressing a proposition situates that proposition within being, and absolute-nothinging can in no way be, hence cannot be situated within being.

Perhaps worth noting at least in passing is that the word “nothing” is non-problematically and indeed often helpfully included within everyday theoretical frameworks relying on ordinary English. For example, “Nothing” can answer the question “What are you doing?”, but this would not mean that the respondent was not breathing, metabolizing, holding their body in some position or other, and so forth, but would instead mean that the respondent was not doing anything that would prevent them from doing something with the questioner. As another example, “There’s nothing in the refrigerator” would not mean that the refrigerator contained no shelves, air, and so forth, but instead that the refrigerator contained nothing that the utterer of the sentence wanted to eat or to drink.

A final word on this topic may be in order. Such sentences as “Nothing might exist” and “There might someday be nothing” are, of course, grammatically non-problematic. From that it does not follow that they are semantically non-problematic. Again, the same holds for “Fred drew a round square.”

8. Being and God

This section is far shorter than the book with which it shares its title, so a reasonable beginning for it is an explanation of the major differences between the two accounts. A thesis central to both accounts is put as follows in Being and God (1): “Any conception of ‘God’ that is not situated within an explicitly presented or implicitly presupposed theory of being as such and as a whole—and hence, obviously, any such conception presented in conjunction with the rejection of such theories—can only be a conception of something or other, an X, that putatively does or does not ‘exist’ beyond the world familiar to us and somehow separately from it, but that cannot ultimately be made either intelligible or reasonable.” Chapter 1 of Being and God criticizes as inade­quate various historical and contemporary approaches to the issue of God that are inadequate because they are not situated within theories of being as such and as a whole; this article includes no such critiques. Chapter 2 of Being and God turns to Heidegger, at the heart of whose thought is the question of being, and it argues at length that Heidegger utterly fails to respond to that question in a philosophically defensible manner; this article does not repeat that critique. Being and God’s Chapter 3 develops the SSP’s theory of absolute being to the point at which coherence and intelligibility are increased by the introduction of the term “God”; this article presents a version of this theory (with minor alterations, and in its different terminology). Chapter 4 of Being and God, finally, criticizes Emmanuel Levinas and Jean-Luc Marion, the most important and influential of those thinkers who attempt—in the language of the central thesis introduced above—to produce conceptions of “God” in conjunction with rejections of theories of being. This article does not consider either Levinas or Marion.

As indicated in the preceding paragraph, the most important way the SSP’s treatment of the issue of God diverges from other treatments of that topic is by situating it within a theory of being as such and as a whole. A second divergence is also worth noting at this point. In contemporary philosophy, the issue “God” is generally treated within what is called the philosophy of religion. According to the SSP, this begs various questions and introduces various unnecessary complica­tions. As is clear from (for example) Plato’s Euthyphro and Aristotle’s Metaphysics, the issue of God (or gods) is—no matter what else it may be—one that can be treated purely theoretically. That is how the SSP treats it. Consequently, the question addressed in this section is the following: does the inclusion of a facting appropriately designated as God increase the coherence and intelligibility of the SSP?

a. The Relation between the Contingent Dimension of Being and the Absolutely Necessary Dimension of Being

Given the preceding clarifications of the modalities of being and the status of absolute nothingness, the SSP’s alternative to the famous but—for reasons just given, incoherent—question “Why is there something rather than nothing?” is easily formulated and explained. The SSP’s question is the following: How is the inclusion within being of a contingently actual dimension best explained? There are in principle only three paths for exploration, and two of those paths are merely apparent. The first merely apparent path does not move beyond the contingently actual dimension of being, and thus leads­—if it can even be said to lead—only to such superficial responses as “Well, there just are contingent be-ers.” The “path” that “leads” to such responses is merely apparent because no such response provides an explanation. The second merely apparent path would lead to the contingently non-actual dimension of being. That is indeed a distinct dimension of being, but it is one that, as non-actual, has no resources that could explain the inclusion within being of a contingently actual dimension and that, as derivative, cannot in any way be the source of any dimension from which it derives. The exclusion of these two merely apparent paths leaves open only the path to the absolutely necessary dimension of being. Because this is the only path, the questions to be asked are the following: how is that path followed, and where does it lead?

The first step along this path consists in determining the relation of the contingent dimension of being to the absolutely necessary dimension of being. According to Structure and Being (454-5, 458), Being and God (234-5), and TAPTOE (171), that relation is one of total dependence. Why? First, to say that the contingently actual dimension of being is independent of the absolutely necessary dimension of being would be to take the first of the two merely apparent paths rejected in the preceding paragraph. What then if the contingently actual dimension of being were said to be partially dependent on the absolutely necessary dimension of being? Such partial dependence is perhaps posited by some accounts of a deus absconditus, according to which God—or, one might say, the absolutely necessary dimension of being—brought the contingently actual dimension of being into being, and then severed relations with it. The problem is that no such account could explain the continu­ation in being of the contingently actual dimension of being; none, that is, could explain why that dimension of being does not cease to be. The thesis that the contingently actual dimension of being is totally dependent on the absolutely necessary dimension of being, however, does explain the continuing being of the contingently actual dimension of being: it is sustained in being by the absolutely necessary dimension of being.

The point made in the preceding paragraph can also be put as follows: being veridically manifests itself, according to SSP, such that it includes both an absolutely necessary dimension and a contingently actual dimension, and such that the latter dimension is totally dependent, for its initial and continuing being, on the former dimension. Challenges to these theses could be only of two sorts. First, it could in principle be argued that the SSP’s theoretical framework would be concretized with greater intelligibility and coherence if one or both of these theses were rejected or altered. Arguments given above in this section at least weigh heavily against any such course of argumentation, and perhaps even show that no such course of argumentation could be viable. Second, an alternative theory of being, lacking any version of the theses introduced at the beginning of this paragraph, could develop within an alternative theoretical framework. Were this to happen, that framework could be evaluated at a meta-systematic level of the SSP. In the absence of such an alternative theory, objections to the SSP’s theory along the lines of “Well, even if it’s the best expla­nation you can come up with, it might not be true” are vacuous. The SSP’s explanation is true, within its theoretical framework, and as true, it articulates factings that are constituents of being.

The next question is, does the total dependence of the contingently actual dimension of being on the absolutely necessary dimension of being make possible the further explication of the absolutely necessary dimension of being? Important to addressing this question is noting the inclusion within the contingently actual dimension of being of human be-ers as be-ers who are, both as thinking and as freely willing, intentionally coextensive with being as such and as a whole, and hence with the absolutely necessary dimension of being. The total dependence of such be-ers on the absolutely necessary dimension of being is however intelligible only if the absolutely necessary dimension of being likewise thinks and freely wills and is thereby intentionally coextensive with being as such and as a whole. Otherwise, what is intelligible to human be-ers would not be intel­ligible to the absolutely necessary dimension of being. The total dependence of human be-ers, in their being, cannot be explained as a relation to a dimension that is in no way cognizant of them or is in any way inferior to them.

The previous paragraph argues that a non-minded absolutely necessary dimension of being is not intelligible as that upon which the contingently actual dimension of being is totally dependent. What, then, of a minded absolutely necessary dimension of being? Such a dimension would not only be cognizant of the contingently actual dimension of being, but would also, as freely willing, be intel­ligible as that upon which the contingently actual dimension of being would be fully dependent: that there is within being a contingently actual dimension is explained by the free willing, by the absolutely necessary dimension of being, that it be.

In part because the contingently actual dimension of being includes human be-ers who make free decisions, the total dependence of that dimension on the free willing of the absolutely necessary dimension of being cannot be one of being determined in all respects. Instead, according to the SSP, what is freely willed by the absolutely necessary dimension of being is the being, as a whole, of the contingently actual dimension of being. This explains the inclusion within the dimension of being as a whole of the contingently actual dimension of being. Explanations of specific phenomena within the contin­gently actual dimension of being, on the other hand, are at least in the overwhelming majority of cases explained by other phenomena within that dimension.

At this point, the following question might be raised: even granting that the only way the inclusion within being of a contingently actual dimension can be explained is by its being freely willed by the absolutely necessary dimension of being, might this explanation nonetheless be false? The first thing to be said in response to this possible objection is that within the theoretical framework of the SSP, the explanation emerges as true. Because it does, it is the case that this is one of the ways in which being veridically manifests itself according to the SSP. The thesis that the inclusion within being of a contingently actual dimension is unintelligible and hence inexplicable cannot be situated within the SSP’s theoretical framework given the centrality, to that framework, of the thesis that being is universally intelligible. This of course does not rule out the possibility of theoretical frameworks within which some such thesis could be included, but if some such framework were to be developed and presented, then it could be assessed in comparison with that of the SSP. Only if it proved superior would the SSP give way to it.

b. God

Once the absolutely necessary dimension of being has been deter­mined to have freely willed the being of the contingently actual dimension of being, and it has been determined, as for example in TAPTOE 5.2, that for be-ers within the contingently actual dimension of being it is good to be, it is appropriate to designate the absolutely necessary dimension of being as God.

To further explain this designation of the absolutely necessary dimension of being as God, it is helpful to introduce the principle of rank within being. This principle is the following:

(PRWB) No facting can arise exclusively from or be explained exclusively by any facting of a lower rank within being.

The rank within being of a given facting is determined by the extent of its sphere of influence, the latter understood as including both what the facting can influence, and what can influence the facting. Given this criterion, rocks have a relatively low rank within being, because (for example) they cannot be influenced by threats from animals or from human be-ers. Because of the ways they interact with other animals and with human be-ers, animals have considerably higher ranks within being than do rocks, but because they cannot be influenced by such things as arguments, they rank well below human be-ers. The sphere of influence of human be-ers has no limits, in that—given that human be-ers are intentionally coextensive with being as such and as a whole—humans can in principle be influenced by any constituent of being, precisely by thinking about it.

From the PRWB and the total dependence of the contingently actual dimension of being on the absolutely necessary dimension of being, it follows that the absolutely necessary dimension of being must be intentionally coextensive with being as such and as a whole, and must be free, because if it were not, then it would be of a lower rank within being than the human be-er.

Once the absolutely necessary dimension of being has been deter­mined to be absolutely freely sustaining the being of the contingently actual dimension of being and to be appropriately designated as God, two additional lines of inquiry open. Following the first would involve confronting the many problems that arise following the intro­duction of God into the SSP; prominent among these is the problem of evil.

The second line of inquiry would require the crossing of a methodological watershed. The reason is that additional determi­nation of the absolutely necessary dimension of being, or of God, may become possible through investigation of the contingently actual dimension of being as wholly dependent on the freedom of God. The question is, does the course of history provide evidence of God’s self­-revelation within it such that the interpretive examination of history will make possible further determination of God—possibly as trinity, and possibly as having been incarnate? Both Structure and Being (459-60) and Being and God (3.7.4.1) identify this interpretive examination of history, which could include interpretive examination of such historical texts as the Bible, as a task for the SSP, but neither pursues this task. Nor does TAPTOE, and nor does this article.

c. The Principle of Rank within Being and Evolution

Biology, relying on its specific theoretical framework, treats specific empirical questions with specific concepts, assumptions, procedures, and so forth. Essential is that it establishes that there has been development within the domain of animals and that among the many stages of this devel­opment there are similarities and dissimilarities. From this it concludes that there are specific connections among these stages. Finally, it inter­prets these connections as constituting a history of descent (particularly: human be-ers descended from some ancestor of the currently extant apes). All of this is correct if it is governed by the qualifier “according to the theoretical framework of biology.” What that means is, among other things, the following: within that framework, only certain questions are addressed; other questions have no place therein. Among these is the following: How is it possible that such an ascending development can have taken place? How is this ascending development ultimately to be explained, particularly given that within it there are be-ers with enormously different ranks within being?

The first and most central thesis that emerges in the SSP’s response to these questions is the following: If a development to higher ranks within being has taken place, then it was possible for it to have taken place. How is this possibility to be explained? First, this possi­bility was always a genuine ontological factor included among the be-ers within the contingently actual dimension of being, where evolution occurs. Already in the earliest and lowest (the purely physical) stages of the cosmos, the possibility for developments to all possible forms and stages, including that for the development of ontologically higher forms, is contained as an immanent factor in the be-ers found at those stages. If this were not the case, then it would be a miracle that these more highly-ranked entities developed as they in fact developed. But how is the immanent ontological status of this possibility of development to be clarified?

The SSP clarifies it as follows: First, comparison of any evolu­tionarily pre-human organism, with its sphere of influence, with any normal adult human be-er, with its sphere of influence, indeed reveals that the human’s sphere of influence is greater, and thereby that the human be-er is of a higher ontological rank (that is, of a higher rank among be-ers). But human be-ers, prior to their emergence in the course of evolution, are not simply absent from the contingently actual dimension of being; they are instead ontologically included within this dimension of being as possibilities, in that if and when the requisite complex configuration of non-human factings emerges, that configuration will be a human be-er. The emergence of human be-ers in the course of evolution is thus nothing like a teleportation from the contingently non-actual dimension of being (or from some merely possible world) into the contingently actual dimension of being. Instead, prior to the emergence of human be-ers in the course of evolution, there be non-human be-ers that have the capacity, in conjunction, to recon­figure themselves such that they cease to be when be-ers of higher ontological ranks, and eventually human be-ers, come to be (this is wholly comparable to the reconfiguration of sperm and egg cells considered above). The span of time, whatever its extent, that precedes the emergence of human be-ers within the contingently actual dimension of being is thus a gestation period for human be-ers. The same holds for organisms of all other kinds.

d. The SSP and Christianity

According to Structure and Being (332), “within the philosophical perspective developed here, Christianity is the incomparably superior religion.” The SSP includes this thesis because Christianity satisfies the following explicitly identified criterion (443): “only Christianity has developed a genuine theology: one that satisfies the highest demands and challenges of theoreticity.” The Christian religion thus provides the theoretician working within the framework of the SSP with a potentially valuable starting point in that Christian theology provides the theoretician with data potentially incorporable into the SSP’s theory of God. That no other religion provides such data is an empirical thesis. If it were shown to be false, or if it were to become false in the future­—if a genuinely theoretical theology linked to any other religion were developed, identified, or discovered—then that theology, too, would provide data potentially incorporable into the SSP, and Christianity would, according to the SSP, cease to be the incomparably superior religion.

In part because Christian theology provides data for potential incorporation into the SSP, Being and God envisages, as the first central question to be addressed as the SSP seeks to further develop its theory of God by examining the history of the contingently actual dimension of being, the question of the degree to which God as articulated by that theory can be identified as the adequately articu­lated biblical-Christian God (see 252-3). It also, however, explicitly recognizes (271-2) the possibility that that degree would be insig­nificant. In addition, theoreticians working to further develop the SSP’s theory of God could focus on religions other than Christianity. Whether historical investigation will make possible further determi­nation of God as articulated by the SSP and, if it does, how closely God, as further determined within the SSP, will resemble the God of any religion, are at this point open questions.

A final remark is in order. It concerns the relation between engaging in philosophy and being of religious faith. The philosopher who as a philos­opher engages in theorization about God may or may not also be of religious faith, Christian or otherwise, and the Christian or person of other religious faith may or may not engage in philosophy. The philosopher who is not of religious faith may or may not be led by theoretical engagement with the issue of God to become of religious faith, Christian or otherwise, and the philosopher who is a Christian or of other religious faith may or may not be led by their theoretical engagement to alter or abandon that faith.

 

9. References and Further Reading

• Gilson, Étienne. (1948) L’Être et L’Essence. Paris : Librairie Philosophique J. Vrin.
• Gilson, Étienne. (1952) Being and Some Philosophers (2nd edition). Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.
• Gilson, Étienne. (2002) Thomism. The Philosophy of Thomas Aquinas. A Translation of Le Thomisme (6th and final edition)
• Kraus, Lawrence. (2012) A Universe from Nothing. Why There Is Something Rather Than Nothing. New York: Free Press.
• Lowe, E. J. (1996), “Why is there anything at all?” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society. Supplementary Volumes. Volume 70: 111-29.
• Puntel, Lorenz B. (2008), Structure and Being. A Theoretical Framework for a Systematic Philosophy. Translated by and in collaboration with Alan White. University Park, PA: Penn State University Press, 2008.
• Puntel, Lorenz B. (2011), Being and God. A Systematic Approach in Confrontation with Martin Heidegger, Emmanuel Levinas, and Jean-Luc Marioni. Translated by and in collaboration with Alan White. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 2011.
• van Inwagen, Peter. (1996), “Why is there anything at all?” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society. Supplementary Volumes. Volume 70: 95-110.
• van Inwagen, Peter. (2008b) Metaphysics (3rd edition). Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
• van Inwagen, Peter. (2009) “Being, Existence, and Ontological Commitment.” In Metametaphysics: New Essays on the Foundations of Ontology, edited by David J. Chalmers, David Manley, and Ryan Wasserman. Oxford: Clarendon, 2009, 472-506.
• White, Alan. (2014) Toward a Philosophical Theory of Everything. Bloomsbury Press.
• White, Alan. (2015) “Rearticulating Being.” Revier of Metaphysics. Volume 69 no. 1: 3-24.

 

Author Information

Alan White
Email: awhite@williams.edu
Williams College
U. S. A.