Charles Darwin (1809–1882)
Charles Darwin is primarily known as the architect of the theory of evolution by natural selection. With the publication of On the Origin of Species in 1859, he advanced a view of the development of life on earth that profoundly shaped nearly all biological and much philosophical thought which followed. A number of prior authors had proposed that species were not static and were capable of change over time, but Darwin was the first to argue that a wide variety of features of the biological world could be simultaneously explained if all organisms were descended from a single common ancestor and modified by a process of adaptation to environmental conditions that Darwin christened “natural selection.”
Although it would not be accurate to call Darwin himself a philosopher, as his training, his professional community, and his primary audience place him firmly in the fold of nineteenth-century naturalists, Darwin was deeply interested and well versed in philosophical works, which shaped his thought in a variety of ways. This foundation included (among others) the robust tradition of philosophy of science in Britain in the 1800s (including, for instance, J. S. Mill, William Whewell, and John F. W. Herschel), and German Romanticism (filtered importantly through Alexander von Humboldt). From these influences, Darwin would fashion a view of the living world focused on the continuity found between species in nature and a naturalistic explanation for the appearance of design and the adaptation of organismic characters to the world around them.
It is tempting to look for antecedents to nearly every topic present in contemporary philosophy of biology in the work of Darwin, and the extent to which Darwin anticipates a large number of issues that remain pertinent today is certainly remarkable. This article, however, focuses on Darwin’s historical context and the questions to which his writings were primarily dedicated.
Table of Contents
- Biography
- Darwin’s Philosophical Influences
- The Argument for Natural Selection
- Evolution, Humans, and Morality
- Design, Teleology, and Progress
- The Reception of Darwin’s Work
- References and Further Reading
1. Biography
Charles Robert Darwin was born in Shropshire, England, on February 12, 1809. He came from a relatively illustrious and well-to-do background: his father, Robert Darwin (1766–1848), was a wealthy and successful surgeon, and his uncle Josiah Wedgwood (1730–1795) was the son of the founder of the pottery and china works that still bear the family name. His grandfather was Erasmus Darwin (1731–1802), a co-founder of the Lunar Society, a group that brought together elite natural philosophers from across the English Midlands, including the chemist Joseph Priestley and the engineers James Watt and Matthew Boulton. Erasmus Darwin’s natural-philosophical poetry was widely known, especially Zoonomia (or “Laws of Life”), published between 1794 and 1796, and containing what we might today call some “proto-evolutionary” thought (Browne 1989).
Darwin had been expected to follow in his father’s footsteps and set out for the University of Edinburgh at the age of sixteen to study medicine. He was, anecdotally, so distressed by surgical demonstrations (in the years prior to anesthesia) that he quickly renounced any thoughts of becoming a doctor and turned his focus instead to the zoological lessons (and collecting exhibitions) of Robert Edmond Grant, who would soon become his first real mentor. Darwin’s father, “very properly vehement against my turning into an idle sporting man, which then seemed my probable destination” (Autobiography, p. 56), sent him in 1828 to Cambridge, with the goal of becoming an Anglican parson. Cambridge, however, would put him in contact with John Stevens Henslow, an influential botanist who encouraged Darwin to begin studying geology.
His friendship with Henslow would trigger one of the pivotal experiences of Darwin’s life. The professor was offered a position as “ship’s naturalist” for the second voyage of the HMS Beagle, a vessel tasked with sailing around the world and preparing accurate charts of the coast of South America. Henslow, dissuaded by his wife from taking the position himself, offered it to Darwin. After convincing his father that there could, indeed, be a career waiting for him at the end of the trip, Darwin departed on December 27, 1831.
Darwin left England a barely credentialed, if promising, twenty-two-year-old student of zoology, botany, and geology. By the time the ship returned in 1836, Darwin had already become a well-known figure among British naturalists. This recognition occurred for several reasons. First, it was a voyage of intellectual transformation. One of Darwin’s most significant scientific influences was Charles Lyell, whose three-volume Principles of Geology arrived by post over the course of the voyage, in the process dramatically reshaping the way in which Darwin would view the geological, fossil, zoological, and botanical data that he collected on the trip. Second, Darwin spent the entire voyage – much of that time in inland South America, while the ship made circuits surveying the coastline – collecting a wide variety of extremely interesting specimens and sending them back to London. Those collections, along with Darwin’s letters describing his geological observations, made him a popular man upon his return, and a number of fellow scientists (including the geologist and fossil expert Richard Owen, later to be a staunch critic of Darwin’s, and the ornithologist John Gould) prepared, cataloged, and displayed these specimens, many of which were extensively discussed in Darwin’s absence.
It was also on this trip that Darwin made his famed visit to the islands of the Galapagos. It is certain that the classic presentation of the Galapagos trip as a sort of “eureka moment” for Darwin, in which he both originated and became convinced of the theory of natural selection in a single stroke by analyzing the beaks of the various species of finch found across several of the islands, is incorrect. (Notably, Darwin had mislabeled several of his collected finch and mockingbird specimens, and it was only after they were analyzed by the ornithologist Gould on his return and supplemented by several other samples collected by the ship’s captain FitzRoy, that he saw the connections between beak and mode of life that we now understand to be so crucial.) But the visit was nonetheless extremely important. For one thing, Darwin was struck by the fact that the organisms found in the Galapagos did not look like inhabitants of other tropical islands, but rather seemed most similar to those found in coastal regions of South America. Why, Darwin began to wonder, would a divine intelligence not create species better tailored to their island environment, rather than borrowing forms derived from the nearby continent? This argument from biogeography (inspired in part by Alexander von Humboldt, about whom more in the next section) was one Darwin always found persuasive, and it would later be included in the Origin.
Beginning with his return in late 1836, and commencing with a flurry of publications on the results of the Beagle voyage that would culminate with the appearance of the book that we now call Voyage of the Beagle (1839, then titled Journal of Researches into the Geology and Natural History of the Various Countries Visited by H.M.S. Beagle), Darwin would spend six fast-paced years moving through London’s scientific circles. This was a period of frantic over-work and rapidly progressing illness (the subject of extreme speculation in the centuries since, with the latest hypothesis being an undiagnosed lactose intolerance). Darwin married his first cousin (a fact that caused him constant worry over the health of his children), Emma Wedgwood, in early 1839, and the family escaped the pressures of London to settle at a country manor in Down, Kent, in 1842 (now renovated as a very attractive museum). Darwin would largely be a homebody from this point on; his poor health and deep attachment to his ten children kept him hearthside for much of the remainder of his career. The death of two of his children in infancy, and especially a third, Annie, at the age of ten, were tragedies that weighed heavily upon him.
Before we turn to Darwin’s major scientific works, it is worth pausing to briefly discuss the extensive evidence revealing the development of Darwin’s thought. Luckily for those of us interested in studying the history of biology, he was a pack-rat. Darwin saved nearly every single letter he received and made pressed copies of those he wrote. He studiously preserved every notebook, piece of copy paper, or field note; we even have lists of the books that he read and when he read them, and some of his children’s drawings, if he later wrote down a brief jot of something on the back of them. As a result, we are able to chronicle the evolution (if you will) of his thinking nearly down to the day.
Thus, we know that over the London period – and particularly during two crucial years, 1837 and 1838 – Darwin would quickly become convinced that his accumulated zoological data offered unequivocal support for what he would call transformism: the idea that the species that exist today are modified descendants of species that once existed in the past but are now extinct. Across the top of his B notebook (started around July 1837), he wrote the word ZOONOMIA, in homage to his grandfather’s own transformist thought. The first “evolutionary tree” would soon follow. Around this time, he came to an understanding of natural selection as a mechanism for transformism, in essentially its modern form – since no organism is exempt from the struggle to survive and reproduce, any advantage, however slight, over its competitors will lead to more offspring in the long run, and hence the accumulation of advantageous change. With enough time, differences large enough to create the gulfs between species would arise.
In 1842, Darwin drafted a short version of this theory (now known as the Sketch) and expanded it to a much longer draft in 1844 (now known as the Essay), which he gave to his wife with instructions and an envelope of money to ensure that it would be published if Darwin died as a result of his persistent health problems. Somewhat inexplicably, he then set this work aside for around a decade, publishing a magisterial three-volume work on the classification of the barnacles. (So all-consuming was the pursuit that one of the Darwin children asked a friend where their father “did his barnacles.”) Hypotheses for the delay abound: aversion to conflict; fear of the religious implications of evolution; the impact of the wide ridicule of the rather slapdash anonymous “evolutionary” volume Vestiges of the Natural History of Creation, published in 1844; or simply a desire to immerse himself fully in the details of a taxonomic project prior to developing his own theoretical perspective.
In any event, he slowly began working on evolutionary ideas again over the mid-1850s (starting to draft a massive tome, likely in the end to have been multi-volume, now known as the Big Book or Natural Selection), until, on June 18, 1858, he received a draft of an article from fellow naturalist Alfred Russel Wallace. Darwin believed – whether or not this is true is another matter – that he had been entirely scooped on natural selection. Without his involvement, Lyell and the botanist Joseph Dalton Hooker arranged a meeting of the Linnean Society at which some of Darwin’s Sketch and Wallace’s paper would be read, allowing Darwin to secure priority in the discovery of natural selection. Meanwhile, Darwin turned to the preparation of an “abstract” of the larger book, much lighter on citations and biological detail than he would have liked, and he rushed it into print. On November 24, 1859, On the Origin of Species by Means of Natural Selection, or the Preservation of Favoured Races in the Struggle for Life was published. Its initial print run immediately sold out.
The book became a massive success, powered in no small part by the ability of natural selection to parsimoniously explain a staggering array of otherwise disunified biological facts (see section 6). He was promoted by a variety of eloquent and influential defenders (such as Thomas Henry Huxley), and even a number of fellow naturalists who were otherwise skeptical (particularly about the theory’s relationship to religious belief) offered him public support.
Despite Darwin’s best efforts (see section 4) to exclude discussion of humans and human evolution from the Origin, both the scientific community and the general public were quick to see the striking impact that Darwin’s work would have on our conception of human origins. After publishing books on the fertilization of orchids, the morphology of climbing plants, and the variation of domesticated plants and animals, Darwin finally turned directly to the question of humans, publishing The Descent of Man in 1871. His efforts there to connect the mental capacities of animals with those of humans would be extended by The Expression of the Emotions in Man and Animals, published the following year, one of the first books to be illustrated with photographic plates. Further books on fertilization, flowers, movement in plants, and a final book on earthworms were Darwin’s remaining major scientific publications – all directed at offering small but important demonstrations of the power of natural selection in action, and the ability of gradual, continuous change to accumulate in significant ways.
Darwin died in April 1882, and is buried in Westminster Abbey, next to John Herschel and just across from Isaac Newton. As such an illustrious burial attests, his legacy as one of the leading scientists of the nineteenth century was immediately cemented, even if the theory of natural selection itself took several decades to meet with universal acceptance (see section 6). By the 1950s, biological theory as a whole had been remade in a largely Darwinian image, and in 1964, Theodosius Dobzhansky would famously write that “nothing makes sense in biology except in the light of evolution.” Darwin was even featured on one side of the British £10 note from 2000 to 2018.
2. Darwin’s Philosophical Influences
For all that Darwin was assuredly not a professional philosopher – as indicated above, his relatively scattered educational trajectory was not one that would have had him reading large numbers of philosophical texts – he was still quite well-read, and concepts from both British and broader European traditions can undeniably be detected in his work. Much debate surrounds the ways in which we should understand those influences, and how they might (or might not) have shaped the content of his later scientific works.
We can be certain that while Darwin studied at Cambridge, he would have received the standard sort of training for a young man interested in becoming a naturalist and an Anglican minister (see Sloan, in Hodge and Radick 2009). He would have studied the Bible, as well as some important works of philosophy (such as John Locke’s Essay). He wrote later in his autobiography about the extent to which reading the natural theology of William Paley had been formative for him—the young Darwin was a genuine admirer of Paley’s approach, and hints of Paley’s perspective on design in nature can be found in the respect with which Darwin would treat arguments concerning the difficulty of accounting for “perfectly” adapted characters like the eye of an eagle.
Darwin also began to engage with the two philosophical traditions that would, as many commentators have noted (see especially Richards and Ruse 2016), largely structure his perspective on the world: one British, consisting of the writings on science by authors like John Herschel, William Whewell, and John Stuart Mill, and one German, which, especially for the young Darwin, would focus on the Romanticism of Alexander von Humboldt.
a. British Philosophy of Science
The British tradition was born out of the professionalization and standardization of scientific practice. Whewell would coin the very term ‘scientist’ around this period, and he and others were engaged in an explicit attempt to clarify the nature of scientific theorizing and inference. Works doing exactly this were published in rapid succession just as Darwin was negotiating the demands of becoming a professional naturalist and fashioning his work for public consumption. Herschel’s Preliminary Discourse on the Study of Natural Philosophy was published in 1830 (Darwin read it the same year), Whewell’s massive History of the Inductive Sciences and Philosophy of the Inductive Sciences appeared in 1837 and 1840, respectively, and Mill’s System of Logic dates from 1843. The very concept of science itself, the ways in which scientific evidence ought to be collected and inferences drawn, and the kinds of character traits that should be possessed by the ideal scientist were all the object of extensive philosophical discourse.
For his part, Darwin certainly was aware of the works of these three authors, even those that he had not read, and was further exposed to them all through their presence in a variety of contemporary scientific texts. Works like Charles Lyell’s Principles of Geology (1830–1833) were self-consciously structured to fulfill all the canons of quality science that had been laid down by the philosophers of the day, and so served as practical exemplars for the kind of theorizing that Darwin would later attempt to offer.
Without going too far afield into the incredibly rich subject of nineteenth-century British philosophy of science, a brief sketch of these views is nonetheless illuminating. In the early years of the 1800s, British science had been left with an uneasy mix of two competing philosophies of science. On the one hand, we find a strict kind of inductivism, often attributed to Francis Bacon, as hardened and codified by Isaac Newton. Scientists are to disinterestedly pursue the collection of the largest possible basis of empirical data and generalize from them only when a theoretical claim has received sufficient evidential support. Such was, the story went, the way in which Newton himself had induced the theory of universal gravitation on the basis of celestial and terrestrial motions, and such was the intent behind his famous injunction, “hypotheses non fingo” – I frame no hypotheses.
Such a philosophy of science, however, ran afoul of perhaps the most significant theoretical development of the early nineteenth century: the construction of the wave theory of light, along with Thomas Young and Augustin Fresnel’s impressive experimental confirmations of the various phenomena of interference. This posed a straightforward set of challenges for British philosophers of science to solve. Other than the famous “crucial experiments” in interference, there was little inductive evidence for the wave theory. What was the medium that transmitted light waves? It seemed to escape any efforts at empirical detection. More generally, was not the wave theory of light exactly the sort of hypothesis that Newton was warning us against? And if so, how could we account for its substantial success? How should the Baconian inductive method be related to a more speculative, deductive one?
Herschel, Whewell, and Mill differ in their approaches to this cluster of questions: Herschel’s emphasis on the role of the senses, Whewell’s invocation of Kantianism, and Mill’s use of more formal tools stand out as particularly notable. But at the most general level, all were trying, among numerous other goals, to find ways in which more expansive conceptions of scientific inference and argument could make room for a “legitimate” way to propose and then evaluate more speculative or theoretical claims in the sciences.
Of course, any theory addressing changes in species over geologic time will confront many of the same sorts of epistemic problems that the wave theory of light had. Darwin’s introduction of natural selection, as we will see below, both profited and suffered from this active discussion around questions of scientific methodology. On the one hand, the room that had been explicitly made for the proposition of more speculative theories allowed for the kind of argument that Darwin wanted to offer. But on the other hand, because so much focus had been aimed at these kinds of questions in recent years, Darwin’s theory was, in a sense, walking into a philosophical trap, with interlocutors primed to point out just how different his work was from the inductivist tradition. To take just one example, Darwin would complain in a letter to a friend that he thought that his critics were asking him for a standard of proof that they did not demand in the case of the wave theory. This conflict will be made explicit in the context of the Origin in the next section.
b. German Romanticism
The other philosophical tradition which substantially shaped Darwin’s thought was a German Romantic one, largely present in the figure of the naturalist, explorer, and philosopher Alexander von Humboldt (1769–1859). Darwin seems to have first read Humboldt in the years between the completion of his bachelor’s degree and his departure on the Beagle. Throughout his life, he often described his interactions with the natural world in deeply aesthetic, if not spiritual, terms, frequently linking such reflections back to Humboldt’s influence. A whole host of Darwin’s writings on the environments and landscapes he saw during his voyage, from the geology of St. Jago (now Santiago) Island in Cape Verde to the rainforests of Brazil, are couched in deeply Humboldtian language.
But this influence was not only a matter of honing Darwin’s aesthetic perception of the world, though this was surely part of Humboldt’s impact. Humboldt described the world in relational terms, focusing in particular on the reciprocal connections between botany, geology, and geography, a perspective that would be central in Darwin’s own work. Humboldt also had expounded a nearly universally “gradualist” picture of life – emphasizing the continuity between animals and humans, plants and animals, and even animate and inanimate objects. As we will see below, this kind of continuity was essential to Darwin’s picture of human beings’ place in the world.
In addition to the widely recognized influence of Humboldt, Darwin knew the works of Carl Gustav Carus, a painter and physiologist who had proposed theories of the unity of type (the sharing of an “archetype” among all organisms of a particular kind, reminiscent as well of the botanical work of Goethe). That archetype theory, in turn, was influentially elaborated by Richard Owen, with whom Darwin would work extensively on the evaluation and classification of some of his fossil specimens after his return on the Beagle. As noted above, Darwin was quite familiar with the work of Whewell, who integrated a very particular sort of neo-Kantianism into the context of an otherwise very British philosophy of science (on this point, see particularly Richards’s contribution to Richards and Ruse 2016).
Controversy exists in the literature over the relative importance of the British and German traditions to Darwin’s thought. The debate in the early twenty-first century is somewhat personified in the figures of Michael Ruse and Robert J. Richards, partisans of the British and German influences on Darwin’s work, respectively. On Ruse’s picture, the British philosophy-of-science context, supplemented by the two equally British cultural forces of horticulture and animal breeding (hallmarks of the agrarian, land-owner class) and the division of labor and a harsh struggle for existence (features of nineteenth-century British entrepreneurial capitalism), offers us the best explanation for Darwin’s intellectual foundations. Richards, of course, does not want to deny the obvious presence of these influences in Darwin’s thought. For him, what marks Darwin’s approach out as distinctive is his knowledge of and facility with German Romantic influences. In particular, Richards argues, they let us understand Darwin’s perennial fascination with anatomy and embryology, aspects that are key in this German tradition and the inclusion of which in Darwin’s work might otherwise remain confusing.
c. Ethical and Moral Theory
Darwin recognized throughout his career that his approach to the natural world would have an impact on our understanding of humans. His later works on the evolution of our emotional, social, and moral capacities, then, require us to consider his knowledge of and relation to the traditions of nineteenth-century ethics.
In 1839, Darwin read the work of Adam Smith, in particular his Theory of Moral Sentiments, which he had already known through Dugald Stewart’s biography of Smith. (It is less likely that he was familiar first-hand with any of Smith’s economic work; see Priest 2017.) Smith’s approach to the moral sentiments – that is, his grounding of our moral conduct in our sympathy and social feelings toward one another – would be reinforced by a work that was meaningful for Darwin’s theorizing but is little studied today: James Mackintosh’s Dissertation on Progress of Ethical Philosophy, published in 1836. For Smith and Mackintosh both, while rational reflection could aid us in better judging a decision, what really inspires moral behavior or right action is the feeling of sympathy for others, itself a fundamental feature of human nature. From his very first reading of Smith, Darwin would begin to write in his notebooks that such an approach to morality would enable us to ground ethical behavior in an emotional capacity that could be compared with those of the animals – and which could have been the target of natural selection.
Finally, we have the influence of Thomas Malthus. Darwin reads Malthus’s Essay on the Principle of Population (1798) on September 28, 1838, just as he is formulating the theory of natural selection for the first time. Exactly what Darwin took from Malthus, and, therefore, the extent to which the reading of Malthus should be seen as a pivotal moment in the development of Darwin’s thought, is a matter of extensive debate. We may be certain that Darwin took from the first chapter of Malthus’s work a straightforward yet important mathematical insight. Left entirely to its own devices, Malthus notes, the growth of population is an exponential phenomenon. On the contrary, even with optimistic assumptions about the ability of humans to increase efficiency and yield in our production of food, it seems impossible that growth in the capacity to supply resources for a given population could proceed faster than a linear increase.
This insight became, as Darwin endeavored to produce a more general theory of change in species, crucial to the conviction that competition in nature – what he would call the struggle for existence – is omnipresent. Every organism is locked in a constant battle to survive and reproduce, whether with other members of its species, other species, or even its environmental conditions (of drought or temperature, for instance). This struggle can help us to understand both what would cause a species to go extinct, and to see why even the slightest heritable advantage could tilt the balance in favor of a newly arrived form.
Of course, Malthus’s book does not end after its first chapter. The reason that this inevitable overpopulation and hardship seems to be absent from much of the human condition, Malthus argues, is because (at least some) humans have been prudent enough to adopt other kinds of behaviors (like religious or social checks on marriage and reproduction) that prevent our population growth from proceeding at its unfettered, exponential pace. We must ensure, he argues, that efforts to improve the lives of the poor in fact actually do so, rather than producing the conditions for problematic overpopulation. A number of commentators, perhaps most famously Friedrich Engels, have seen in this broader “Malthusianism” the moral imprint of upper-class British society. Others, by contrast, have argued that Darwin’s context is more complex than this, and requires us to carefully unpack his relationship to the multi-faceted social and cultural landscape of nineteenth-century Britain as a whole (see Hodge 2009 and Radick, in Hodge and Radick 2009).
3. The Argument for Natural Selection
Famously, Darwin described the Origin as consisting of “one long argument” for his theory of evolution by natural selection. From the earliest days of its publication, commentators were quick to recognize that while this was assuredly true, it was not the kind of argument that was familiar in the scientific method of the day.
a. Darwin’s Theory
The first question to pose, then, concerns just what Darwin is arguing for in the Origin. Strikingly, he does not use any form of the term “evolution” until the very last word of the book; he instead has a penchant for calling his position “my view” or “my theory.” Contemporary scholars tend to reconstruct this theory in two parts. First, there is the idea of descent with modification. It was common knowledge (more than a century after the taxonomic work of Linnaeus, for example) that the species that exist today seem to show us a complex network of similarities, forming a tree, composed of groups within groups. Darwin’s proposal, then, is that this structure of similarity is evidence of a structure of ancestry – species appear similar to one another precisely because they share common ancestors, with more similar species having, in general, shared an ancestor more recently. Carrying this reasoning to its logical conclusion, then, leads Darwin to propose that life itself was “originally breathed into a few forms or into one” (Origin, p. 490).
The second argumentative goal of the Origin is to describe a mechanism for the production of the changes which have differentiated species from one another over the history of life: natural selection. As organisms constantly vary, and those variations are occasionally more or less advantageous in the struggle for existence, the possessors of advantageous variations will find themselves able to leave more offspring, producing lasting changes in their lineage, and leading in the long run to the adaptation and diversification of life.
Before turning to the argument itself, it is worth offering some context: what were the understandings of the distribution and diversity of life that were current in the scientific community of the day? Two issues here are particularly representative. First, the question of ‘species.’ What exactly was the concept of species to which Darwin was responding? As John Wilkins (2009) has argued, perhaps the most common anecdotal view – that prior to Darwin, everyone believed that species were immutable categories handed down by God – is simply not supported by the historical evidence. A variety of complex notions of species were in play in Darwin’s day, and the difficulty of interpretation here is compounded by the fact that Darwin’s own notion of species is far from clear in his works (there is debate, for example, concerning whether Darwin believed species categories were merely an epistemic convenience or an objective fact about the natural world). In short, Darwin was not as radical on this score as he is sometimes made out to be, in part because there was less theoretical consensus around the question of species than we often believe.
Second, there is the question of ‘gradualism.’ As we have seen, Darwin was heavily influenced by the geologist Charles Lyell, whose Principles of Geology argued for a gradualist picture of geological change (see Herbert 2005 on Darwin’s connections and contributions to geology). Rather than a history of “catastrophes” (Rudwick 1997), where major upheavals are taken to have shaped the geological features we see around us, Lyell argued for the contrary, “uniformitarian” view, on which the same geological causes that we see in action today (like erosion, earthquakes, tidal forces, and volcanic activity), extended over a much longer history of the Earth, could produce all of today’s observed phenomena. Lyell, however, had no interest in evolution. For him, species needed a different causal story: “centers of creation,” where the divine creative power was in the process of building new species, would counterbalance extinctions caused by steady change in the distribution of environmental and climatic conditions across the globe. It is easy to see, however, how Darwin’s own view of evolution by the gradual accumulation of favorable variations could fit naturally into a Lyellian picture of geological and environmental change. Darwin is, in many ways, a product of his time.
b. The Origin of Species
The Origin begins, then, with an analogy between artificial selection – as practiced by agricultural breeders, horticulturalists, or, Darwin’s favorite example, keepers of “fancy” pigeons – and natural selection. Consider for a moment how exactly artificial selection produces new varieties. We have an idea in mind for a new variation that would be aesthetically pleasing or practically useful. Well-trained observers watch for offspring that are born with characteristics that tend in this direction, and those organisms are then bred or crossed. The process repeats and – especially in the nineteenth century, when much work was ongoing to standardize or regularize commercially viable agricultural stocks – modifications can be realized in short order. Of course, this kind of breeding requires the active intervention of an intellect to select the organisms involved, and to plan for the “target” in mind. But this need not be the case. The goal could easily be removed; Darwin has us imagine cases where a simple inclination to keep one’s “best” animals safe during storms or other periods of danger could similarly create selective breeding of this sort, though now with an “unconscious” goal. Furthermore, Darwin will argue, the “selector” can also be done away with.
The next step in the analogy, then, is to demonstrate how such selection could be happening in the natural world. Organisms in nature do seem to vary just as our domestic plants and animals do, he argues – appearances to the contrary are likely just consequences of the fact that the kind of extreme attention to variation in characteristics that an animal breeder gives to their products is absent for wild populations. In just the same way that a breeder will ruthlessly cull any organisms that do not present desirable characters, organisms in the natural world are locked in a brutal struggle for existence. Far more organisms are born than can possibly survive, leading to a kind of Malthusian competition among conspecific organisms, and, in a variety of situations, struggles against the environment itself (heat, cold, drought, and so on) are also severe. Thus, all of the ingredients are there for the analogy to go through: the generation of variation, the relevance of that variation for survival, and the possibility for this process of selection to create adaptation and diversification.
Natural selection, then, because it can work not only on the kinds of visible characters that are of concern to the horticulturalist or animal breeder, but also on the internal construction of organisms, and because it selects for general criteria of success, not limited human goals, will be able to produce adaptations entirely beyond the reach of artificial selection. The result, Darwin writes, “is as immeasurably superior to man’s feeble efforts, as the works of Nature are to those of Art” (Origin, p. 61).
How exactly should we understand this analogy? What kind of evidential or logical support does Darwin think it brings to the process of natural selection? Analogical arguments were increasingly popular throughout the nineteenth century. In part, this may be traced back to Aristotelian and other Greek uses of analogy, which would have been familiar to Darwin and his peers. The role of analogy in the formulation of causal explanations in science had also been emphasized by authors like Herschel and Mill, who argued that one step in proposing a novel causal explanation was the demonstration of an analogy between its mode of action and other kinds of causes we already know to be present in nature.
Darwin then turns to a discussion of an array of objections that he knew would have already occurred to his contemporary readers. For instance: If species arose through gradual transitions, why are they now sharply distinguished from one another? Specialization and division of labor would produce increased opportunities for success and would thus tend to drive intermediate forms to extinction. How could natural selection possibly have created organs like the eyes of an eagle, whose extreme level of perfection had indicated to authors like Paley the signature of design? With enough time, if the intervening steps along the way were still useful to the organisms that possessed them, even such organs could be produced by a gradual process of selection. Darwin also considers the appearance of instincts, with the aim of demonstrating that natural selection could influence mental processes, and the supposed infertility of hybrids, which could be seen as a problem for the accumulation of variation by crossing.
Next comes a discussion of the imperfection of the geological record. The relative rarity, Darwin argues, of the conditions required for fossilization, along with our incomplete knowledge of the fossils that are present even in well explored regions like Europe and North America, explains our ignorance of the complete set of transitional forms connecting ancestral species with the organisms alive today. This, then, serves as a segue to a collection of diverse, positive arguments for evolution by natural selection at the end of the volume, often likened to a Whewell-inspired “consilience of inductions” (a demonstration that a number of independent phenomena, not considered when the theory was first proposed, all serve as evidence for it). A number of facts about the distribution of fossils makes more sense on an evolutionary picture, Darwin argues. Extinction is given a natural explanation as an outcome of competition, and the relations between extinct groups seem to follow the same kinds of patterns that natural selection successfully predicts to exist among living species.
This final “consilience” portion of the book continues by discussing geographical distribution. Rather than appearing as though they were specifically created for their environments, Darwin notes, the flora and fauna of tropical islands are closely affiliated with the species living on the nearest major continent. This indicates that normal means of dispersal (floating, being carried by birds, and so on), along with steady evolution by natural selection, offers a solid explanation for these distributional facts. Similarly, the Linnaean, tree-like structure of larger groups containing smaller groups which relates all extant species can be explained by common ancestry followed by selective divergence, rather than simply being taken to be a brute fact about the natural world. Brief discussions of morphology, embryology, and rudimentary organs close this section, followed by a summary conclusion.
Darwin’s argument for evolution by natural selection is thus a unique one. It combines a number of relatively different ingredients: an analogy with artificial selection, several direct rebuttals of potential counterarguments, and novel evolutionary explanations for a variety of phenomena that are taken to be improvements on the consensus at that time. The ways in which these arguments relate to one another and to the evidential base for natural selection are sometimes made explicit, but sometimes left as exercises for the reader. Darwin’s critics saw in this unorthodox structure an avenue for attack (about which more in section 6).
The character of Darwin’s argument has thus remained an interpretive challenge for philosophers of science. One can recognize in the elements from which the argument is constructed the influence of particular approaches to scientific reasoning – for instance, Herschel’s understanding of the vera causa tradition, Comte’s positivism, or Whewell’s development of the consilience of inductions. These clues can help us to construct an understanding of Darwin’s strategy as being in dialogue with the contemporary philosophy of his day. How to spell this out in the details, however, is relatively challenging, especially because Darwin was himself no philosopher, and it can thus be difficult to determine to what extent he was really engaging with the details of any one philosopher’s work.
In a different vein, we can also use the Origin as a test case for a variety of contemporary pictures of scientific theory change. To take just one example, Darwin seems at times to offer an explicit argument in support of the epistemic virtues embodied by his theory. In particular, he directly considers the likely fertility of an evolutionary approach, arguing that future biological research in an evolutionary vein will be able to tackle a whole host of new problems that are inaccessible on a picture of special creation.
Similarly, evolutionary theory can serve as a test case for our understanding of scientific explanation in the context of historical sciences. Darwin’s argument relies crucially upon the ability to generalize from a local, short-term explanation (of, for instance, the creation of a new kind of pigeon by the accumulation of variations in a particular direction) to a long-term explanation of a broad trend in the history of life (like the evolution of flight). Darwin’s twin reliance on both this sense of “deep time” and on explanations that often involve not the description of a specific causal pathway (one that Darwin could not have possibly known in the mid-nineteenth century) but of a narrative establishing the plausibility of an evolutionary account for a phenomenon have since been recognized to be at the heart of a variety of scientific fields (Currie 2018).
4. Evolution, Humans, and Morality
Throughout the Origin, Darwin assiduously avoids discussion of the impact of evolutionary theory on humans. In a brief aside near the end of the conclusion, he writes only that “light will be thrown on the origin of man and his history” (Origin, p. 488). Of course, no reader could fail to notice that an evolutionary account of all other organisms, along with a unified mechanism for evolution across the tree of life, implies a new account of human origins as well. Caricatures of Darwin depicted as a monkey greeted the theory immediately upon its publication, and Darwin – whose notebooks and correspondence show us that he had always believed that human evolution was one of the most pressing questions for his theory to consider, even if it was absent from the Origin – finally tackled the question head-on when he published the two-volume Descent of Man, and Selection in Relation to Sex in 1871.
a. The Question of Human Evolution
It is important to see what Darwin’s explanatory goals were in writing the Descent. In the intervening years since publishing the Origin (which was, at this point, already in its fifth edition, and had been substantially revised as he engaged with various critics), Darwin had remained convinced that his account of evolution and selection was largely correct. He had published further volumes on variation in domesticated products and the fertilization of orchids, which he took to secure even further his case for the presence of sufficient variation in nature for natural selection to produce adaptations. What, then, was left to describe with respect to human beings? What made human beings special?
It should be emphasized that humans did not merit an exception to Darwin’s gradualist, continuous picture of life on earth. There is no drastic difference in kind – even with respect to emotions, communication, intellect, or morality – that he thinks separates human beings from the other animals. The Descent is not, therefore, in the business of advancing an argument for some special distinguishing feature in human nature.
On the contrary, it is this very gradualism that Darwin believes requires a defense. Opposition to his argument for continuity between humans and the other animals came from at least two directions. On the one hand, religious objections were relatively strong. Any picture of continuity between humans and animals would, for many theologians, have to take the human soul into account. Constructing an account of this supposedly distinctive feature of human beings which could be incorporated into a narrative of human evolution was certainly possible – many authors did precisely this (see Livingstone 2014) – but would require significant work (see more on religious responses to Darwin in section 6.b).
On the other hand, and more problematic from Darwin’s perspective, was scientific opposition, perhaps best represented by Alfred Russel Wallace, who argued that the development of human mental capacity had given us the ability to exempt ourselves from natural selection’s impact on our anatomy entirely (on the Darwin-Wallace connection, see Costa 2014). This special place for human reason did not sit well with Darwin, who thought that natural selection would act no differently in the human case. (Wallace would go on to become a spiritualist, a bridge too far for Darwin; the men rarely communicated afterward.)
Further, as has been extensively, if provocatively, maintained by Desmond and Moore (2009), Darwin recognized the moral stakes of the question. The debate over the origins of human races was raging during this period, dividing those who believed that all human beings were members of a single species (monogenists) and those who argued that human races were in fact different species (polygenists). Darwin came from an abolitionist, anti-slavery family (his wife’s grandfather, the founder of the Wedgwood pottery works, famously produced a series of “Am I Not a Man and a Brother?” cameos, which became an icon of the British and American anti-slavery movements). He had seen first-hand the impact of slavery in South America during the Beagle voyage and was horrified. Desmond and Moore’s broader argument, that Darwin’s entire approach to evolution (in particular, his emphasis on common ancestry) was molded by these experiences, has received harsh criticism. But the more limited claim that Darwin was motivated at least to some extent by the ethical significance of an evolutionary account of human beings is inarguable.
b. The Descent of Man
The Descent therefore begins with a demonstration of the similarity between the physical and mental characteristics of humans and other animals. Darwin notes the many physical homologies (that is, parts that derive from the same part in a common ancestor) between humans and animals – including a number of features of adults, our processes of embryological development, and the presence of rudimentary organs that seem to be useful for other, non-human modes of life. When Darwin turns to the intellect, he notes that, of course, even when we compare “one of the lowest savages” to “one of the higher apes,” there is an “enormous” difference in mental capacity (Descent, p. 1:34). Nonetheless, he contends once again that there is no difference in kind between humans and animals. Whatever mental capabilities we consider (such as instincts, emotions, learning, tool use, or aesthetics), we are able to find some sort of analogy in animals. The mixture of love, fear, and reverence that a dog shows for his master, Darwin speculates, might be analogous with humans’ belief in God (Descent, p. 1:68). As regards the emotions in particular, Darwin would return to this subject a year later in his work The Expression of the Emotions in Man and Animals, a full treatise concerning emotional displays in animals and their similarities with those in humans.
Of course, demonstrating that it is possible for these faculties to be connected by analogy with those in animals is not the same thing as demonstrating how such faculties might have evolved for the first time in human ancestors who lacked them. That is Darwin’s next goal, and it merits consideration in some detail.
For Darwin, the evolution of higher intellectual capacities is intimately connected with the evolution of social life and the moral sense (Descent, pp. 1:70–74). We begin with the “social instincts,” which primarily consist of sympathy and reciprocal altruism (providing aid to fellow organisms in the hope of receiving the same in the future). These would do a tolerably good job of knitting together a sort of pre-society, though obviously they would extend only to the members of one’s own “tribe” or “group.” Social instincts, in turn, would give rise to a feeling of self-satisfaction or dissatisfaction with one’s behavior, insofar as it aligned or failed to align with those feelings of sympathy. The addition of communication or language to the mix allows for social consensus to develop, along with the clear expression of public opinion. All these influences, then, could be intensified as they became habits, giving our ancestors an increasingly intuitive feeling for the conformity of their behavior with these emerging social norms.
In short, what we have just described is the evolution of a moral sense. From a basic kind of instinctive sympathy, we move all the way to a habitual, linguistically encoded sense of praise or blame, an instinctive sentiment that one’s actions should or should not have been done, a feeling for right and wrong. Darwin hastens to add that this evolutionary story does not prescribe the content of any such morality. That content will emerge from the conditions of life of the group or tribe in which this process unfolds, in response to whatever encourages or discourages the survival and success of that group. Carried to the extreme, Darwin writes that if people “were reared under precisely the same conditions as hive-bees, there can hardly be a doubt that our unmarried females would, like the worker-bees, think it a sacred duty to kill their brothers, and mothers would strive to kill their fertile daughters; and no one would think of interfering” (Descent, p. 1:73).
There is thus no derivation here of any particular principle of normative ethics – rather, Darwin wants to tell us a story on which it is possible, consistent with evolution, for human beings to have cobbled together a moral sense out of the kinds of ingredients which natural selection can easily afford us. He does argue, however, that there is no reason for us not to steadily expand the scope of our moral reasoning. As early civilizations are built, tribes become cities, which in turn become nations, and with them an incentive to extend our moral sympathy to people whom we do not know and have not met. “This point being once reached,” Darwin writes, “there is only an artificial barrier to prevent his sympathies extending to the men of all nations and races” (Descent, pp. 1:100–101).
We still, however, have not considered the precise evolutionary mechanism which could drive the development of such a moral sense. Humans are, Darwin argues, assuredly subject to natural selection. We know that humans vary, sometimes quite significantly, and experience in many cases (especially in the history of our evolution, as we are relatively frail and defenseless) the same kinds of struggles for existence that other animals do. There can be little doubt, then, that some of our features have been formed by natural selection. But the case is less obvious when we turn to mental capacities and the moral sense. In some situations, there will be clear advantages to survival and reproduction acquired by the advancement of some particular mental capacity – for instance, the ability to produce a device for obtaining food or performing well in battle.
The moral sense, however, offers a more complicated case. Darwin recognizes what is sometimes called the problem of biological altruism – that is, it seems likely that selfish individuals who freeload on the courage, bravery, and sacrifice of others will be more successful and leave behind more offspring than those with a more highly developed moral sense. If this is true, how can natural selection have favored the development of altruistic behavior? The correct interpretation of Darwin’s thinking here is the matter of a fierce debate in the literature. Darwin’s explanation seems to invoke natural selection operating at the level of groups or tribes. “When two tribes of primeval man, living in the same country, came into competition,” he writes, “if the one tribe included (other circumstances being equal) a greater number of courageous, sympathetic, and faithful members, who were always ready to warn each other of danger, to aid and defend each other, this tribe would without doubt succeed best and conquer the other” (Descent, p. 1:162). This appears to refer to natural selection not in terms of individual organisms competing to leave more offspring, but of groups competing to produce more future groups, a process known as group selection. On the group-selection reading, then, what matters is that the moral sense emerges in a social context. While individually, a selfish member of a group might profit, a selfish tribe will be defeated in the long-run by a selfless one, and thus tribes with moral senses will tend to proliferate.
Michael Ruse has, however, argued extensively for a tempering of this intuitive reading. Given that in nearly every other context in which Darwin discusses selection, he focuses on the individual level (even in cases like social insects or packs of wolves, where a group-level reading might be attractive), we should be cautious in ascribing a purely group-level explanation here. Among other considerations, the humans (or hominids) who formed such tribes would likely be related to one another, and hence a sort of “kin selection” (the process by which an organism promotes an “extended” version of its own success by helping out organisms that are related to it, and hence an individual-level explanation for apparent group-level phenomena) could be at play.
c. Sexual Selection
Notably, the material described so far has covered only around half of the first volume of the Descent. At this point, Darwin embarks on an examination of sexual selection – across the tree of life, from insects, to birds, to other mammals – that takes up the remaining volume and a half. He does so in order to respond to a unique problem that human beings pose. There is wide diversity in human morphology; different human races and populations look quite different. That said, this diversity seems not to arise as a result of the direct impact of the environment (as similar-looking humans have lived for long periods in radically different environments). It also seems not to be the sort of thing that can be explained by natural selection: there is nothing apparently adaptive about the different appearances of different human groups. How, then, could these differences have evolved?
Darwin answers this question by appealing to sexual selection (see Richards 2017). In just the same way that organisms must compete with others for survival, they must also compete when attracting and retaining mates. If the “standards of beauty” of a given species were to favor some particular characteristic for mating, this could produce change that was non-selective, or which even ran counter to natural selection. The classic example here is the tail of the peacock: even if the tail imposes a penalty in terms of the peacock’s ability to escape from predators, if having an elaborate tail is the only way in which to attract mates and hence to have offspring, the “selection” performed by peahens will become a vital part of their evolutionary story. A variety of non-selective differences in humans, then, could be described in terms of socially developed aesthetic preferences.
This explanation, too, has been the target of extensive debate. It is unclear whether or not sexual selection is a process that is genuinely distinct from natural selection – after all, if natural selection is intended to include aptitude for survival and reproduction, then it seems as though sexual selection is only a subset of natural selection. Further, the vast majority of Darwin’s examples of sexual selection in action involve traditional, nineteenth-century gender roles, with an emphasis on violent, aggressive males who compete for coy, choosy females. Can the theory be freed of these now outmoded assumptions, or should explanations that invoke sexual selection instead be discarded in favor of novel approaches that take more seriously the insights of contemporary theories of gender and sexuality (see, for instance, Roughgarden 2004)?
5. Design, Teleology, and Progress
Pre-Darwinian concepts of the character of life on earth shared a number of what we might call broad-scale or structural commitments. Features like the design of organismic traits, the use of teleological explanations, or an overarching sense of progress stood out as needing explanation in any biological theory. Many of these would be challenged by an evolutionary view. Darwin was aware of such implications of his work, though they are often addressed only partially or haphazardly in his most widely read books.
a. Design: The Darwin-Gray Correspondence
One aspect of selective explanations has posed a challenge for generations of students of evolutionary theory. The production of variations, as Darwin himself emphasized, is a random process. While he held out hope that we would someday come to understand some of the causal sequences in greater detail (as we indeed now do), in the aggregate it is “mere chance” that “might cause one variety to differ in some character from its parents” (Origin, p. 111). On the other hand, natural selection is a highly non-random process, which generates features that seem to us to be highly refined products of design.
Darwin, of course, recognized this tension, and discussed it at some length – only he did not do so, in general, in the context of his published works. It is his correspondence with the American botanist Asa Gray which casts the most light on Darwin’s thought on the matter (for an insightful recounting of the details, see Lennox 2010). Gray was what we might today call a committed “theistic evolutionist” – he believed that Darwin’s theory might be largely right in the details but hoped to preserve a role for a master plan, a divinely inspired design lying behind the agency of natural selection (which would on this view have been instituted by God as a secondary cause). Just as, many theists since Newton had argued, God might have instituted the law of gravity as a way to govern a harmonious balance in the cosmos, Gray wondered if Darwin might have discovered the way in which the pre-ordained, harmonious balance in the living world was governed.
However, this would require a place for the “guidance” of design to enter, and Gray thought that variation was where it might happen. If, rather than being purely random, variations were guided, directed toward certain future benefits or a grand design, we might be able to preserve divine influence over the evolutionary process. Such a view is entirely consistent with what Darwin had written in the Origin. He often spoke of natural selection in precisely the “secondary cause” sense noted above (and selected two quotes for the Origin’s frontispiece that supported precisely this interpretation), and he stated clearly that what he really meant in calling variation “random” was that we were entirely ignorant of its causes. Could not this open a space for divinely directed evolution?
Darwin was not sure. His primary response to Gray’s questioning was confusion. He wrote to Gray that “in truth I am myself quite conscious that my mind is in a simple muddle about ‘designed laws’ & ‘undesigned consequences.’ — Does not Kant say that there are several subjects on which directly opposite conclusions can be proved true?!” (Darwin to Gray, July 1860, in Lennox 2010, p. 464). Darwin’s natural-historical observations seem to show him that nature is a disorderly, violent, dangerous place, not exactly one compatible with the kind of design that his British Anglican upbringing had led him to expect.
Another source is worthy of note. In his 1868 Variation in Plants and Animals Under Domestication, Darwin asks us to consider the example of a pile of stones that has accumulated at the base of a cliff. Even though we might call them “accidental,” the precise shapes of the stones in the pile are the result of a series of geological facts and physical laws. Now imagine that someone builds a building from the stones in the pile, without reshaping them further. Should we infer that the stones were there for the sake of the building thus erected? Darwin thinks not. “An omniscient Creator,” he writes, “must have foreseen every consequence which results from the laws imposed by Him. But can it be reasonably maintained that the Creator intentionally ordered, if we use the words in any ordinary sense, that certain fragments of rock should assume certain shapes so that the builder might erect his edifice?” (Variation, p. 2:431). Variation, Darwin claims, should be understood in much the same way. There is no sense, divine or otherwise, in which the laws generating variation are put in place for the sake of some single character in some particular organism. In this sense, evolution is a chancy (and hence undesigned) process for Darwin.
b. Was Darwin a Teleologist?
A related question concerns the role of teleological explanation in a Darwinian world. Darwin is often given credit (for example, by Engels) for having eliminated the last vestiges of teleology from nature. A teleological account of hearts, for instance, takes as a given that hearts are there in order to pump blood, and derives from this fact explanations of their features, their function and dysfunction, and so on. (See the discussion of final causes in the entry on Aristotle’s biology.) From the perspective of nineteenth-century, post-Newtonian science, however, such a teleological explanation seems to run contrary to the direction of causation. How could the fact that a heart would go on to pump blood in the future explain facts about its development now or its evolution in the past? Any such explanation would have to appeal either to a divine design (which Darwin doubted), or to some kind of vitalist force or idealist structure preexisting in the world.
A truly “Darwinian” replacement for such teleology, it is argued, reduces any apparent appeals to “ends” or “final causes” to structures of efficient causation, phrased perhaps in terms of the selective advantage that would be conferred by the feature at issue, or a physical or chemical process that might maintain the given feature over time. The presence of these structures of efficient causation could then be explained by describing their evolutionary histories. In this way, situations that might have seemed to call for teleological explanation are made intelligible without any appeal to final causes.
This does seem to be the position on teleology that was staked out by Darwin’s intellectual descendants in mid-twentieth century biology (such as Ernst Mayr). But is this Darwin’s view? It is not clear. A compelling line of argumentation (pursued by philosophers like James Lennox and David Depew) notes the presence of a suspiciously teleological sort of explanation that runs throughout Darwin’s work. For Darwin, natural selection causes adaptations. But the fact that an adaptation is adaptive also often forms part of an explanation for its eventual spread in the population. There is thus a sense in which adaptations come to exist precisely because they have the effect of improving the survival and reproduction of the organisms that bear them. There is no mistaking this as a teleological explanation – just as we explained hearts by their effect of pumping blood, here we are explaining adaptations by the effects they have on future survival and reproduction.
There are thus two questions to be disentangled here, neither of which have consensus responses in the contemporary literature. First, did Darwin actually advocate for this kind of explanation, or are these merely turns of phrase that he had inherited from his teachers in natural history and to which we should give little actual weight? Put differently, did Darwin banish teleology from biology or demonstrate once and for all the way in which teleology could be made compatible with an otherwise mechanistic understanding of the living world? Second, does contemporary biology give us reasons to reject these kinds of explanations today, or should we rehabilitate a revised notion of teleology in the evolutionary context (for the latter perspective, see, for instance, Walsh 2016)?
c. Is Natural Selection Progressive?
The observation of “progress” across the history of life is a reasonably intuitive one: by comparison to life’s first billion years, which exclusively featured single-celled, water-dwelling organisms, we are now surrounded by a bewildering diversity of living forms. This assessment is echoed in the history of philosophy by way of the scala naturae, the “great chain of being” containing all living things, ordered by complexity (with humans, or perhaps angels, at the top of the scale).
This view is difficult to reconcile with an evolutionary perspective. In short, the problem is that evolution does not proceed in a single direction. The bacteria of today have been evolving to solve certain kinds of environmental problems for just as long, and with just as much success, as human beings and our ancestors have been evolving to solve a very different set of environmental challenges. Any “progress” in evolution will thus be progress in a certain, unusual sense of “complexity.” In the context of contemporary biology, however, it is widely recognized that any one such ordering for all of life is extremely difficult to support. A number of different general definitions of “complexity” have been proposed, and none meets with universal acceptance.
Darwin acknowledged this problem himself. Sometimes he rejected the idea of progress in general. “It is absurd,” he wrote in a notebook in 1837 (B 74), “to talk of one animal being higher than another.” “Never speak of higher and lower,” he wrote as a marginal note in his copy of Robert Chambers’s extremely progressivist Vestiges of the Natural History of Creation. Other times, he was more nuanced. As he had written at the beginning of notebook B, among his earliest evolutionary thoughts: “Each species changes. [D]oes it progress? […] [T]he simplest cannot help – becoming more complicated; & if we look to first origin there must be progress.” When life first begins, there is an essentially necessary increase in complexity (a point emphasized in the contemporary context by authors like Stephen Jay Gould and Daniel McShea), as no organism can be “less complex” than some minimal threshold required to sustain life. Is this “progress?” Perhaps, but only of a very limited sort.
These quotes paint a picture of Darwin as a fairly revolutionary thinker about progress. Progress in general cannot be interpreted in an evolutionary frame; we must restrict ourselves to thinking about evolutionary complexity; this complexity would have been essentially guaranteed to increase in the early years of life on earth. Adaptation refines organismic characteristics within particular environments, but not with respect to any kind of objective, global, or transcendental standard. If this were all Darwin had said, he could be interpreted essentially as consistent with today’s philosophical reflections on the question of progress.
But this is clearly not the whole story. Darwin also seemed to think that this restricted notion of progress as increase in complexity and relative adaptation was related to, if not even equivalent to, progress in the classical sense – and that such progress was in fact guaranteed by natural selection. “And as natural selection works solely by and for the good of each being,” he wrote near the end of the Origin, “all corporeal and mental endowments will tend to progress toward perfection” (Origin, p. 489). The best way to interpret this trend within Darwin’s writing is also the matter of some debate. We might think that Darwin is here doing his best to extract from natural selection some semblance (even if relativized to the local contexts of adaptation to a given environment) of the notion of progress that was so culturally important in Victorian Britain. Or, we might argue, with Robert Richards, that natural selection has thus retained a sort of moral, progressive force for Darwin, a force that might have been borrowed from the ideas of progress present within the German Romantic tradition.
6. The Reception of Darwin’s Work
Darwin’s work was almost immediately recognized as heralding a massive shift in the biological sciences. He quickly developed a group of colleagues who worked to elaborate and defend his theory in the British and American scientific establishment of the day. He also, perhaps unsurprisingly, developed a host of critics. First, let us consider Darwin’s scientific detractors.
a. Scientific Reception
Two facts about the Origin were frequent targets of early scientific critique. First, despite being a work on the origin of species, Darwin never clearly defines what he means by ‘species.’ Second, and more problematically, Darwin attempts to treat the generation and distribution of variations as a black box. One of the goals of the analogy between artificial and natural selection (and Darwin’s later writing of the Variation) is to argue that variation is simply a brute fact about the natural world: whenever a potential adaptation could allow an organism to advantageously respond to a given selective pressure or environmental change, Darwin is confident that the relevant variations could at least potentially arise within the population at issue.
However, as a number of his critics noted (including, for instance, J. S. Mill), it seems to be this process of the generation of variation that is really responsible for the origin of species. If the variation needed for selection to respond is not available, then evolutionary change simply will not occur. It is thus impossible, these critics argued, to have an account of evolution without a corresponding explanation of the generation of variations – or, at the very least, any such account would be incapable of demonstrating that any particular adaptation could actually have been produced by natural selection.
Another vein of scientific criticism concerned Darwin’s evidence base. The classic inductivism that was part and parcel of much of nineteenth-century British philosophy of science (see section 2.a) seems not to be satisfied by Darwin’s arguments. Darwin could not point to specific examples of evolution in the wild. He could not describe a detailed historical sequence of transitional forms connecting an ancestral species with a living species. He believed that he could tell portions of those stories, which he took to be sufficient, but this did not satisfy some critics. And he could not describe the discrete series of environmental changes or selection pressures that led to some particular evolutionary trajectory. Of course, these sorts of evidence are available to us today in a variety of cases, but that was of no help in 1859. Darwin was thus accused (for instance, in a scathing review of the Origin by the geologist Adam Sedgwick) of having inverted the proper order of explanation and having therefore proposed a theory without sufficient empirical evidence.
These scientific appraisals led to a period that has been called (not uncontroversially) the “eclipse of Darwinism” (a term coined by Julian Huxley in the mid-twentieth century; see Bowler 1992). It is notable that almost all of them are related to natural selection, not to the question of common ancestry. The vast majority of the scientific establishment quickly came to recognize that Darwin’s arguments for common ancestry and homology were extremely strong. There was thus a span of several decades during which Darwin’s “tree of life” was widely accepted, while his mechanism for that tree’s generation and diversification was not, even by scientific authorities as prestigious as Darwin’s famed defender Thomas Henry Huxley or the early geneticist T. H. Morgan. A host of alternative mechanisms were proposed, from neo-Lamarckian proposals of an inherent drive to improvement, to saltationist theories that proposed that variation proceeded not by gradual steps, but by large jumps between different forms. It was only with the integration of Mendelian genetics and the theory of evolution in the “Modern Synthesis” (developed in the 1920s and 1930s) that this controversy was finally laid to rest (see, for instance, Provine 1971).
b. Social and Religious Reception
The religious response to Darwin’s work is a complex subject, and was shaped by theological disputes of the day, local traditions of interaction (or lack thereof) with science, and questions of personal character and persuasion (see Livingstone 2014). Some religious authors were readily able to develop a version of natural selection that integrated human evolution into their picture of the world, making space for enough divine influence to allow for the special creation of humans, or at least for human souls. Others raised precisely the same kinds of objections to Darwin’s philosophy of science that we saw above, as they, too, had learned a sort of Baconian image of scientific methodology which they believed Darwin violated. But acceptance or rejection of Darwin’s theory was by no means entirely determined by religious affiliation. A number of figures in the Church of England at the time (an institution that was in the middle of its own crisis of modernization and liberalization) were themselves already quite willing to consider Darwin’s theory, or were even supporters, while a number of Darwin’s harshest critics were no friends to religion (Livingstone 2009).
Simplistic stories about the relationship between evolution and religious belief are thus very likely to be incorrect. The same is true for another classic presentation of religious opposition to Darwin, which is often used to reduce the entire spectrum of nuanced discussion to two interlocutors at a single event: the debate between Bishop Samuel (“Soapy Sam”) Wilberforce and Thomas Henry Huxley, held at the Oxford University Museum on the 30th of June, 1860. Wilberforce famously asked Huxley whether it was through his grandfather’s or grandmother’s side that he had descended from monkeys. As the classic story goes, Huxley calmly laid out the tenets of Darwin’s theory in response, clearly demonstrated the misunderstandings upon which Wilberforce’s question rested, and replied that while he was not ashamed to have descended from monkeys, he would be “ashamed to be connected with a man [Wilberforce] who used his great gifts to obscure the truth.” Huxley retired to thunderous applause, having carried the day.
The only trouble with this account is that it is almost certainly false. There are very few first-hand accounts of what actually took place that day, and many that exist are likely biased toward one side or the other. Huxley’s reputation had much to gain from his position as a staunch defender of science against the Church, and thus a sort of mythologized version of events was spread in the decades that followed the exchange. A number of attendees, however, noted rather blandly that, other than the monkey retort (which he did almost certainly say), Huxley’s remarks were unconvincing and likely interested only those already committed Darwinians (Livingstone 2009).
The Scopes Trial, another oft-cited “watershed” moment in the relationship between evolutionary theory and the general public, is also more complex than it might first appear. As Adam Shapiro (2013) has persuasively argued, the Scopes Trial was about far more than simple religious opposition to evolutionary theory (though this was certainly an ingredient). Biology had become part of a larger discussion of educational reform and the textbook system, making any hasty conclusions about the relationship between science and religion in this case difficult to support.
In summary, then, caution should be the order of the day whenever we attempt to analyze the relationship between religion and evolutionary theory. Religious institutions, from Darwin’s day to our own, are subject to a wide array of internal and external pressures, and their responses to science are not often made on the basis of a single, clear decision about the theological or scientific merits of some particular theory. This is especially true in Darwin’s case. Darwin’s theory quickly became part of larger social and cultural debates, whether these were about science and education (as in the United States), or, as was true globally, about broader ideological issues such as secularism, scientific or methodological naturalism, and the nature of the power and authority that scientists should wield in contemporary society.
There are few studies concerning the reception of Darwin by the public at large. Perhaps the most incisive remains that by the linguist Alvar Ellegård (1958), though his work only concerns the popular press in Britain for the first thirteen years after the publication of the Origin. This reaction is largely what one might have expected: the work itself was largely ignored until its implications for human evolution and theology were more widely known. At that point, natural selection remained largely either neglected or rejected, and public reactions were, in general, shaped by preexisting social structures and intellectual or cultural affiliations.
c. Darwin and Philosophy
Philosophers were quick to realize that Darwin’s work could have impacts upon a whole host of philosophical concerns. Particularly quick to respond were Friedrich Nietzsche and William James, both of whom were incorporating evolutionary insights or critiques into their works very shortly after 1859. The number of philosophical questions potentially impacted by an evolutionary approach is far too large to describe here and would quickly become an inventory of contemporary philosophy. A few notable examples will have to suffice (for more, see Smith 2017).
Biological species had, since Aristotle, been regularly taken to be paradigmatic exemplars of essences or natural kinds. Darwin’s demonstration that their properties have been in constant flux throughout the history of life thus serves as an occasion to reexamine our very notions of natural kind and essence, a task that has been taken up by a number of metaphysicians and philosophers of biology. When applied to human beings, this mistrust of essentialism poses questions for the concept of human nature. The same is true for final causes and teleological explanations (see section 5.b), where evolutionarily inspired accounts of function have been used to rethink teleological explanations across philosophy and science.
More broadly, the recognition that human beings are themselves evolved creatures can be interpreted as a call to take much more seriously the biological bases of human cognition and experience in the world. Whether this takes the form of a fully-fledged “neurophilosophy” (to borrow the coinage of Patricia Churchland) or simply the acknowledgement that theories of perception, cognition, rationality, epistemology, ethics, and beyond must be consistent with our evolved origins, it is perhaps here that Darwin’s impact on philosophy could be the most significant.
7. References and Further Reading
a. Primary Sources
- Nearly all of Darwin’s works, including his published books, articles, and notebooks, are freely available at Darwin Online: <http://darwin-online.org.uk>
- Darwin’s correspondence is edited, published, and also digitized and made freely available by a project at the University of Cambridge: <https://www.darwinproject.ac.uk/>
- Darwin, Charles. 1859. On the Origin of Species by Means of Natural Selection, or the Preservation of Favoured Races in the Struggle for Life. 1st ed. London: John Murray.
- The first edition of Darwin’s Origin is now that most commonly read by scholars, as it presents Darwin’s argument most clearly, without his extensive responses to later critics.
- Darwin, Charles. 1862. On the Various Contrivances by Which British and Foreign Orchids Are Fertilised by Insects. London: John Murray.
- The work on orchids offers insight into Darwin’s thought on coadaptation and the role of chance in evolution.
- Darwin, Charles. 1868. The Variation of Animals and Plants Under Domestication. 1st ed. London: John Murray.
- A two-volume work concerning the appearance and distribution of variations in domestic products.
- Darwin, Charles. 1871. The Descent of Man, and Selection in Relation to Sex. 1st ed. London: John Murray.
- Two-volume treatise on the evolution of humans, intelligence, morality, and sexual selection.
- Darwin, Charles. 1872. The Expression of the Emotions in Man and Animals. London: John Murray.
- An argument for continuity in emotional capacity between humans and the higher animals.
- Barlow, Nora, ed. 1958. The Autobiography of Charles Darwin, 1809–1882. London: Collins.
- Darwin’s autobiography, while occasionally of dubious historical merit, remains an important source for our understanding of his personal life.
b. Secondary Sources
- Bowler, Peter J. 1992. The Eclipse of Darwinism: Anti-Darwinian Evolution Theories in the Decades around 1900. Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.
- Explores the various debates surrounding natural selection and variation in the period from around Darwin’s death until the development of the early Modern Synthesis in the 1920s.
- Browne, Janet. 1995. Charles Darwin: Voyaging, vol. 1. New York: Alfred A. Knopf.
- Browne, Janet. 2002. Charles Darwin: The Power of Place, vol. 2. New York: Alfred A. Knopf.
- The most detailed and highest quality general biography of Darwin, across two volumes loaded with references to published and archival materials.
- Browne, Janet. 1989. “Botany for Gentlemen: Erasmus Darwin and ‘The Loves of the Plants.’” Isis 80: 593–621.
- A presentation of the literary and social context of Darwin’s grandfather Erasmus’s poetic work on taxonomy and botany.
- Costa, James T. 2014. Wallace, Darwin, and the Origin of Species. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- A careful discussion of the long relationship between Wallace and Darwin, ranging from the early proposal of natural selection to Wallace’s later defenses of natural and sexual selection, and forays into spiritualism.
- Currie, Adrian. 2018. Rock, Bone, and Ruin: An Optimist’s Guide to the Historical Sciences. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
- An exploration of the conceptual issues posed by scientific explanation in the “historical sciences” (such as evolution, geology, and archaeology), from a contemporary perspective.
- Desmond, Adrian, and James Moore. 2009. Darwin’s Sacred Cause: How a Hatred of Slavery Shaped Darwin’s Views on Human Evolution. Houghton Mifflin Harcourt.
- Provocative biography of Darwin arguing that his development of evolution (in particular, his reliance on common ancestry) was motivated by his anti-slavery attitude and his exposure to the slave trade during the Beagle voyage.
- Ellegård, Alvar. 1958. Darwin and the General Reader: The Reception of Darwin’s Theory of Evolution in the British Periodical Press, 1859–1872. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- A wide-ranging study of the impact of Darwin’s works in the popular press of his day.
- Herbert, Sandra. 2005. Charles Darwin, Geologist. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Thorough presentation of Darwin’s work as a geologist, extremely important to his early career and to his development of the theory of natural selection.
- Hodge, M. J. S. 2009. “Capitalist Contexts for Darwinian Theory: Land, Finance, Industry and Empire.” Journal of the History of Biology 42 (3): 399–416. https://doi.org/10.1007/s10739-009-9187-y.
- An incisive discussion of the relationship between Darwin’s thought and the varying economic and social paradigms of nineteenth-century Britain.
- Hodge, M. J. S., and Gregory Radick, eds. 2009. The Cambridge Companion to Darwin. 2nd ed. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- A broad, well written, and accessible collection of articles exploring Darwin’s impact across philosophy and science.
- Lennox, James G. 2010. “The Darwin/Gray Correspondence 1857–1869: An Intelligent Discussion about Chance and Design.” Perspectives on Science 18 (4): 456–79.
- Masterful survey of the correspondence between Charles Darwin and Asa Gray, a key source for Darwin’s thoughts about the relationship between evolution and design.
- Livingstone, David N. 2014. Dealing with Darwin: Place, Politics, and Rhetoric in Religious Engagements with Evolution. Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.
- A discussion of the wide diversity of ways in which Darwin’s religious and theological contemporaries responded to his work, with a focus on the importance of place and local tradition to those responses.
- Livingstone, David N. 2009. “Myth 17: That Huxley Defeated Wilberforce in Their Debate over Evolution and Religion.” In Numbers, Ronald L., ed., Galileo Goes to Jail: And Other Myths about Science and Religion, pp. 152–160. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- A brief and extremely clear reconstruction of our best historical knowledge surrounding the Huxley/Wilberforce “debate.”
- Manier, Edward. 1978. The Young Darwin and His Cultural Circle. Dordrecht: D. Riedel Publishing Company.
- While somewhat dated now, this book still remains a rich resource for the context surrounding Darwin’s intellectual development.
- Priest, Greg. 2017. “Charles Darwin’s Theory of Moral Sentiments: What Darwin’s Ethics Really Owes to Adam Smith.” Journal of the History of Ideas 78 (4): 571–93.
- Explores the relationship between Adam Smith’s ethics and Darwin’s, arguing that Darwin did not derive any significant insights from Smith’s economic work.
- Provine, William B. 1971. The Origins of Theoretical Population Genetics. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
- Classic recounting of the historical and philosophical moves in the development of the Modern Synthesis, ranging from Darwin to the works of R. A. Fisher and Sewall Wright.
- Richards, Evelleen. 2017. Darwin and the Making of Sexual Selection. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- A carefully constructed history of Darwin’s development of sexual selection as it was presented in The Descent of Man, presented with careful and detailed reference to the theory’s social and cultural context.
- Richards, Robert J., and Michael Ruse. 2016. Debating Darwin. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- A volume constructed as a debate between Richards and Ruse, both excellent scholars of Darwin’s work and diametrically opposed on a variety of topics, from his intellectual influences to the nature of natural selection.
- Roughgarden, Joan. 2004. Evolution’s Rainbow: Diversity, Gender, and Sexuality in Nature and People. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
- A rethinking of Darwin’s theory of sexual selection for the contemporary context, with an emphasis on the reconstruction of biological explanations in the light of contemporary discussions of gender and sexuality.
- Rudwick, M. J. S. 1997. Georges Cuvier, Fossil Bones, and Geological Catastrophes. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- Describes the conflict between “uniformitarian” and “catastrophist” positions concerning the geological record in the years just prior to Darwin.
- Ruse, Michael, and Robert J. Richards, eds. 2009. The Cambridge Companion to the “Origin of Species.” Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- An excellent entry point into some of the more detailed questions surrounding the structure and content of Darwin’s Origin.
- Shapiro, Adam R. 2013. Trying Biology: The Scopes Trial, Textbooks, and the Antievolution Movement in American Schools. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- Insightful retelling of the place of the Scopes Trial in the American response to evolutionary theory, emphasizing a host of other, non-scientific drivers of anti-evolutionary sentiment.
- Smith, David Livingstone, ed. 2017. How Biology Shapes Philosophy: New Foundations for Naturalism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- This edited volume brings together a variety of perspectives on the ways in which biological insight has influenced and might continue to shape contemporary philosophical discussions.
- Walsh, Denis M. 2016. Organisms, Agency, and Evolution. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Develops a non-standard view of evolution on which teleology and organismic agency are given prominence over neo-Darwinian natural selection and population genetics.
- Wilkins, John S. 2009. Species: A History of the Idea. Berkeley: University of California Press.
- A discussion of the history of the concept of species, useful for understanding Darwin’s place with respect to other theorists of his day.
Author Information
Charles H. Pence
Email: charles@charlespence.net
Université Catholique de Louvain
Belgium