Divine Hiddenness Argument against God’s Existence

The “Argument from Divine Hiddenness” or the “Hiddenness Argument” refers to a family of arguments for atheism. Broadly speaking, these arguments try to demonstrate that, if God existed, He would (or would likely) make the truth of His existence more obvious to everyone than it is. Since the truth of God’s existence is not as obvious to everyone as it should be if God existed, proponents of arguments from divine hiddenness conclude that God must not (or probably does not) exist. While there is disagreement about how obvious God would make His existence, all the most prominent arguments from divine hiddenness maintain that God would (or would likely) make Himself obvious enough to everyone that nonbelief (or particular kinds of nonbelief) in God’s existence would not occur (or would not be nearly as common).

While the “argument from divine hiddenness” refers to a family of arguments for atheism, that term is often used interchangeably with the term “problem of divine hiddenness”. But the “problem of divine hiddenness” may refer to a much broader range of concerns than arguments for atheism. For example, those who want to believe in God’s existence, but who find themselves unable to believe, may experience pain or anxiety because of their lack of belief. This pain or anxiety can be considered an experiential problem of divine hiddenness, even if these nonbelievers never consider their own nonbelief as a piece of evidence against God’s existence. While other problems of divine hiddenness are briefly addressed at the end of this article, the bulk of what follows discusses hiddenness in the context of arguments for atheism.

Table of Contents

1. Arguments from Divine Hiddenness
   1. J.L. Schellenberg’s Argument from Divine Hiddenness
   2. Other Arguments from Divine Hiddenness
2. Responses to the Arguments from Divine Hiddenness
   1. There is no Nonbelief (of the Wrong Kind)
   2. Personal Relationship with God does not Require Belief that God Exists
   3. Greater Goods and Other Reasons God Might Hide
   4. Other Responses
3. Divine Hiddenness and Specific Faith Traditions
4. Other Problems of Divine Hiddenness
5. References and Further Reading

1. Arguments from Divine Hiddenness

As implied above, there is no single “argument from divine hiddenness”, but instead there are several arguments from divine hiddenness. Assuming that the primary concern of proponents of arguments for divine hiddenness involves nonbelief as it occurs in the actual world, the simplest version of a deductive argument from divine hiddenness might be formulated in the following way:

IP: If God exists, then nonbelief does not occur.

EP: Nonbelief occurs.

Therefore,

C: God does not exist.

While no one has proposed a version of the argument as simple as this, it demonstrates the basic structure that virtually all deductive arguments from hiddenness have at their core. First, they have an “incompatibility” premise (IP) which identifies two states of affairs that are supposed to be incompatible with each other: the existence of God (on some conception of “God”) and the occurrence of some kind of “nonbelief phenomenon”. A nonbelief phenomenon could include patterns of nonbelief, such as the geographic or temporal distribution of nonbelief, as well as different kinds of nonbelief, such as “nonresistant” or “reasonable” nonbelief. Second, deductive hiddenness arguments have an “existential” premise (EP) which states that the nonbelief phenomenon specified in the incompatibility premise occurs in the actual world. From this, all deductive arguments from hiddenness conclude that God (as understood by the conception of God specified by the incompatibility premise) does not exist.

Inductive arguments from hiddenness follow a similar pattern, but differ from the deductive pattern above in at least one of a couple of ways, as seen in the following simplified version of an inductive hiddenness argument:

IPP: If nonbelief exists then, probably, God does not.

PP: Nonbelief probably exists.

Therefore,

C: God probably does not exist.

Some inductive arguments from hiddenness, in place of an incompatibility premise, have an “improbability premise” (IPP). Improbability premises state that the existence of some nonbelief phenomenon makes some variety of theism less likely than we might have initially thought. Improbability premises may make even bolder claims than this, as seen in the sample improbability premise above (IPP), but they are at least this bold. Improbability premises might be spelled out in a few different ways. For example, some improbability premises might argue that nonbelief (of a certain kind) is more likely on atheism than on theism, all else being equal, and therefore counts as evidence of atheism, while other improbability premises may argue that the probability of God existing given the existence of nonbelief is less than the probability of God existing given no nonbelief. Arguments with an improbability premise can also be called evidential arguments, since they take the occurrence of the nonbelief phenomenon as evidence that God does not exist. Some inductive arguments from hiddenness, in place of an existential premise, may have a “probability premise” (PP), which states that the nonbelief phenomenon in question probably exists in the actual world. And so, there are at least three basic models for inductive arguments from hiddenness, since it is also possible to have an inductive argument from hiddenness with both an improbability premise and a probability premise (as seen above). Depending on which adjustments are made, the conclusion will have to be adjusted accordingly. For further discussion of inductive arguments from divine hiddenness—especially evidential arguments—see Anderson and Russell (2021).

Considering deductive and inductive arguments, there are already several different arguments from divine hiddenness one could make. The number of potential arguments from divine hiddenness increases considerably when we factor in the two variables in the basic structure of hiddenness arguments. Arguments from divine hiddenness can vary with regards to which conception of God is under consideration, and which nonbelief phenomenon is under consideration. Of course, most potential arguments from divine hiddenness have not been defended, but this framework allows us to recognize the common structure that virtually all arguments from divine hiddenness share.

There is one final and important way that we can draw distinctions between the various arguments from divine hiddenness: how they defend their core premises. Different arguments provide different reasons for thinking that God’s existence (under a certain conception) is incompatible with a particular nonbelief phenomenon. And different arguments will provide different reasons for thinking that the nonbelief phenomenon in question actually occurs.

a. J.L. Schellenberg’s Argument from Divine Hiddenness

The most commonly discussed argument from divine hiddenness was proposed and primarily defended by J.L. Schellenberg. While Schellenberg has gone through numerous formulations of his argument from divine hiddenness, the basic idea has remained the same. Schellenberg’s core argument is that, if God exists, then, necessarily, there will be no nonresistant nonbelief. But since nonresistant nonbelief exists, we must conclude that God does not.

Viewing this argument in light of the framework established above, we can identify the nonbelief phenomenon that Schellenberg is concerned with as nonresistant nonbelief. Initially, Schellenberg used the terms reasonable nonbelief and inculpable nonbelief (Schellenberg 1993). But later he clarified reasonable/inculpable nonbelief as one species of a broader kind of nonbelief which he labeled “nonresistant nonbelief” (Schellenberg 2007). It should be noted that the term “nonresistant nonbelief” is primarily employed by Schellenberg (and those defending or responding to his argument) for the sake of simplicity. “Nonresistant nonbeliever” is really a shorthand for someone who is (i) not resisting God and (ii) capable of a meaningful conscious relationship with God, and yet who does not (iii) believe that God exists (Schellenberg 2007).

On Schellenberg’s usage, “God” refers to the concept you end up with if you suppose that there is an “ultimate being” who is also a person. From this, it follows at least that God is a perfect person. That is, God is perfect in all the properties appropriate to persons, including (but not limited to) power, knowledge, creativity, and love. Schellenberg takes this concept of God to be the traditional concept of God as understood by major western monotheistic religions, but warns against taking too much from tradition. He argues that we should not include anything in our idea of God that conflicts with the central idea of God as the ultimate, perfect person.

So, the core of Schellenberg’s argument is that, necessarily, God (as the ultimate, perfect person) would ensure that there are no nonresistant nonbelievers, but since there actually are nonresistant nonbelievers, we must conclude that God does not exist.

One distinguishing feature of Schellenberg’s argument is the way he supports the claim that God would ensure that there are no nonresistant nonbelievers. He claims that this simply follows as a logically necessary entailment of his concept of God as the ultimate, perfect person. Since a perfect personal God would be perfect in love, any personal creatures God creates would, necessarily, be created as an expression of that love, and towards the end of loving and being loved by God. In other words, God would create persons for the purpose of engaging in positively meaningful conscious relationships with God. It follows, necessarily, according to Schellenberg, that such a God, would do everything He could to prevent any created persons from being deprived of the possibility of such relationship. Since a conscious relationship with God necessarily requires that one believes that God exists, God would do everything He could to prevent created persons from failing to believe that God exists. And since God’s perfections would also include perfect power and knowledge, it follows that only culpable resistance to belief on the part of an individual person could prevent God from ensuring that all persons believe in His existence. It should be noted that Schellenberg makes a concession here by assuming that God might allow culpably resistant belief, because he knows many will balk at the idea that God would either force belief in His existence on those who resist it or, alternatively, create humans without the free will to resist God in the first place. Schellenberg himself, however, doubts that God would create free will of the sort that would allow resistance to belief in God (Schellenberg 2004, 2007). Keeping that concession in mind, it follows that, if such a God exists, then, necessarily, the only kind of nonbelief that should exist is resistant nonbelief. In other words, there would be no nonresistant nonbelief.

The idea that God would ensure that no nonresistant nonbelief occurs because He would always make a relationship with Himself available to all created persons has become the focal point of much of the hiddenness literature, with much discussion focusing on defending or refuting this idea specifically. But it is important to note that the class of hiddenness arguments, in general, do not obviously stand or fall based solely on whether this idea turns out to be right.

A common formal statement of Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument is as follows:

Necessarily, if God exists, anyone who is (i) not resisting God and (ii) capable of meaningful conscious relationship with God is also (iii) in a position to participate in such relationship (able to do so just by trying). (PREMISE)

Necessarily, one is at a time in a position to participate in meaningful conscious relationship with God only if at that time one believes that God exists. (PREMISE)

Necessarily, if God exists, anyone who is (i) not resisting God and (ii) capable of meaningful conscious relationship with God also (iii) believes that God exists. (From 1 and 2)

There are (and often have been) people who are (i) not resisting God and (ii) capable of meaningful conscious relationship with God without also (iii) believing that God exists. (PREMISE)

God does not exist (Schellenberg 2007).

For an in-depth examination of Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument, how its fine details have developed over time, and much of the discussion it has prompted, see Veronika Weidner (2018).

b. Other Arguments from Divine Hiddenness

While most of the literature on the problem of divine hiddenness concerns itself with Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument, there are several other notable hiddenness arguments.

One of the earliest hiddenness arguments of note comes from Theodore Drange. Drange’s argument is inductive, rather than deductive, and it specifically targets God as conceived by evangelical Christianity. The nonbelief phenomenon he claims as evidence against the existence of such a God is the sheer amount of nonbelief in that God. The idea is that, on evangelical Christianity, it seems that God wants everyone to believe that He exists, and it seems very likely that God could do much more to ensure a much greater number of people believe that He exists. If those two propositions are true, then it’s very likely that if such a God did exist, then there would be far fewer people who lacked belief in the existence of the God. God would ensure that there were fewer nonbelievers. But since so many people do lack belief in God’s existence, Drange concludes that it’s very likely that God (as conceived of by evangelical Christians) does not exist (Drange 1993).

Drange offers several reasons for thinking that God (as conceived by Evangelical Christians) would want everyone to believe in His existence, but the one with perhaps the most intuitive force is that, according to the Bible, belief in God is necessary to achieve salvation. Since evangelical Christians also believe that God wants everyone to be saved, it follows that God would want to ensure that everyone believes in His existence. A somewhat similar argument is made by Greg Janzen (2011).

Stephen Maitzen proposes an evidential hiddenness argument in which he suggests that the uneven distribution of theism, both geographically and historically, is much more likely on naturalism than on theism. The sort of theism he takes as his target conceives of God as a personal creator who is unsurpassably loving. He argues that, on this sort of theism, it would be quite unlikely for it to be the case that, in some parts of the world, theism is exceptionally common, while in other parts of the world, theism is exceptionally uncommon. But he notes that this is exactly the kind of world in which we find ourselves. As an overwhelmingly Muslim nation, Saudi Arabia, for example, is around 95% theistic, while Thailand, an overwhelmingly Buddhist nation, has very few theists, at most comprising 5% of the population (Maitzen 2006). This disparity of theistic belief between different parts of the world seems surprising if God exists and loves everyone equally. But it is not at all surprising on naturalism, since, on naturalism, theism primarily spreads person-to-person and its spread is heavily influenced by history, culture, and geographic proximity between groups of people, and there is no force for spreading theism that can transcend those influences. Thus, the uneven distribution of theism provides some evidence for naturalism and some evidence against theism.

While Maitzen never criticizes other hiddenness arguments, he notes that one virtue of his argument is that it easily avoids most of the criticisms made against other arguments from divine hiddenness. For example, while certain responses to hiddenness arguments claim that nonbelief arises from one’s own culpability, Maitzen notes that we can’t extrapolate that to a global scale. It seems highly unlikely that one part of the world would have such a high concentration of culpable nonbelievers compared with another part of the world. And even if God has some good reason for allowing nonbelief (see below for more on these responses), it would still be surprising that God’s reasons allowed for so much nonbelief in one part of the world but allowed for very little nonbelief in another part of the world (Maitzen 2006).

Another notable hiddenness argument comes from Jason Marsh. He considers a nonbelief phenomenon he dubs “natural nonbelief”. Natural nonbelief is the belief-state pre-historic humans were in (with regards to God’s existence) prior to the emergence of anything even close to the relatively modern concept of monotheism. The idea here is that, for a large proportion of the history of human existence, humans lacked not only the concept of an ultimate creator God with unsurpassable power, intelligence, and love, they lacked even the concept of a “theistic-like” god: a “high” god with significant power, knowledge etc. (though not to the maximal degree), who may or may not exist alongside but above lower gods. And so, for much of human existence, all humans were nonbelievers in the existence of not just a monotheistic God, but also any sort of high god at all. To use Marsh’s term, they were natural nonbelievers. Marsh thinks that the existence of so many natural nonbelievers is highly unlikely if a God exists who is conceived of in the way that most modern monotheists conceive of Him, since natural nonbelief precludes the possibility of personal relationship with such a God (whereas believers in a “high god” of some kind, even though it would turn out they do not fully understand God, might still have the possibility for a relationship with God as conceived of by monotheists, if such a God existed).  By contrast, the occurrence of natural nonbelief is not at all unlikely if naturalism is true. Thus, the existence of so much natural nonbelief provides evidence against theism and for naturalism (Marsh 2013).

2. Responses to the Arguments from Divine Hiddenness

Given that, at their core, hiddenness arguments have two central premises, any response to an argument from divine hiddenness must deny one of its two central premises. Responses to deductive hiddenness arguments must deny either the claim that the existence of God is incompatible with the existence of some stated nonbelief phenomenon, or they must deny that the stated nonbelief phenomenon occurs. Responses to inductive arguments from divine hiddenness may involve several different strategies, depending on what sort of inductive argument is in question. For inductive arguments with one probabilistic premise and one non-probabilistic premise, responses may simply deny the non-probabilistic premise. For inductive arguments with an “improbability premise”, responses may argue that the existence of God is not rendered significantly less likely due to the occurrence of some nonbelief phenomenon. For inductive arguments with a “probability premise”, responses may argue that the probability that the nonbelief phenomenon in question really does occur in the actual world is lower than the probability premise in question claims. Since some inductive arguments may have one probabilistic premise and one non-probabilistic premise, responses to those sorts of evidential arguments may also deny the non-probabilistic premise. Those sorts of responses will resemble responses to deductive hiddenness arguments. In practice, many of the replies to hiddenness arguments are implied to be relevant to inductive or deductive hiddenness arguments, even though they often directly address a deductive hiddenness argument.

Although most prominent hiddenness arguments, such as those defended by Drange, Maitzen, and Marsh, have received some direct engagement in the literature, most responses to hiddenness arguments target Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument specifically, or some generalized hiddenness argument that strongly resembles Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument. This usually involves one of three strategies. First, some authors attempt to cast doubt on the claim that Schellenberg’s proposed nonbelief phenomenon actually occurs. Second, some authors argue that personal relationship with God (of a positively meaningful sort) is possible even without belief that God exists, and thus for that reason God does not need to eliminate nonresistant nonbelief, which would undercut Schellenberg’s support for his claim that if God exists then there is no nonresistant nonbelief. Third (and most commonly), many authors try to propose some reason God might have for withholding (at least temporarily) the possibility of a meaningfully positive conscious relationship with God. And if God has a reason for withholding such a relationship, that reason will also constitute a reason that God might sometimes withhold belief from people despite a lack of resistance on their part.

The following section discusses each of these kinds of responses in turn.

a. There is no Nonbelief (of the Wrong Kind)

Some authors have responded to Schellenberg by denying that there is reasonable nonbelief, inculpable nonbelief, or nonresistant nonbelief. Given that Schellenberg did not initially use the term “nonresistant nonbelief” (as defined above), some responses of this kind do not directly target nonresistant nonbelief, but nonbelief understood in light of previous terms used by Schellenberg, such as “reasonable nonbelief” or “inculpable nonbelief”. Schellenberg maintains that many such responses have misunderstood what sort of nonbelief phenomenon he had in mind, which motivated him to use the label “nonresistant nonbelief” and further clarify what exactly he means by that label (Schellenberg 2007). Due to this misunderstanding, responses targeting (for example) “reasonable nonbelief” might fail to address the concept Schellenberg actually has in mind (i.e. nonresistant nonbelief, as defined above).

Douglas Henry, for example, argues that reasonable nonbelief is not likely to exist. A reasonable nonbeliever who is aware of the question of God’s existence would recognize the importance of that question and take the time to adequately investigate whether God exists. This should involve not just armchair philosophy, but a more active search for evidence or arguments outside of what one is able to consider on one’s own. But Henry notes that, given the importance of the question of God’s existence, it is unlikely that many nonbelievers (if any) have conducted an adequate investigation into finding the answer. He concludes that it is not likely that a large number of reasonable nonbelievers exists, and adds that he suspects that there are no reasonable nonbelievers (Henry 2001).

But, as noted above, Schellenberg has clarified that the sort of nonbelief he is concerned with is nonresistant nonbelief more broadly, not just reasonable nonbelief. One might fail to adequately investigate the question of God’s existence, not due to any active resistance to God, but something else. For example, a failure to properly recognize the priority of the question compared with other pursuits in one’s life, or an inability to adequately investigate or even recognize whether one’s investigation is adequate. There are also geographically isolated nonbelievers who do not even know about the question of God’s existence, and so do not know there is anything to investigate (Schellenberg 2007). So, it seems that, even if there is a reason for thinking that reasonable nonbelief does not exist, it is still possible that nonresistant nonbelief exists, and Henry’s reply fails to demonstrate that Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument is unsound.

Ebrahim Azadegan provides an argument denying that inculpable nonbelief exists. His idea is that every case of nonbelief occurs due to sin. By acting wrongly, we develop wrong desires and a proneness to act in ways we know are wrong. Some of those desires conflict with what we know we ought to do if God exists (Azadegan 2013). How might this demonstrate that there is no inculpable nonbelief? It could be that desires that conflict with what we know we ought to do if God exists can blind us when assessing the evidence for God’s existence, leading us to favour nonbelief. If one’s sin in this way leads one to nonbelief, then that nonbelief is culpable, argues Azadegan. Thus, since plausibly everyone has done wrong, it might be that all nonbelief results from a bias towards nonbelief, due to a desire to act in ways that are wrong if God exists.

Tyler Taber and Tyler Dalton McNabb offer a somewhat similar response, arguing that divine hiddenness is not a problem for reformed epistemologists. They argue that divine hiddenness simply amounts to the problem of sin’s consequences (Taber and McNabb 2016). V. Martin Nemoianu also argues along similar lines that there are no nonresistant nonbelievers, defending Pascal’s view that God’s hiddenness from us is primarily due to our own choices (Nemoianu 2016).

While the above arguments were global in scale, in that they attempt to use premises that could apply to all apparent nonresistant nonbelievers, there is another style of argument that may cast doubt on claims that certain particular individuals are nonresistant nonbelievers, even when those individuals honestly self-identify as nonresistant nonbelievers. This sort of argument appeals to evidence from various sources which seems to show that people often need more evidence than expected in order to accept beliefs of certain kinds. Miles Andrews, for example, cites findings from psychology that show that we are bad at predicting how we will respond to being confronted with evidence. While we may think, “If I had evidence of type X, then I would believe,” we are often wrong about that, and may not believe even when confronted with evidence of type X (Andrews 2014). Another example of an argument like this comes from Jake O’Connell, who points to historical cases of people witnessing what they themselves believed to be miracles, and yet who did not come to believe that God exists. O’Connell argues that this provides some reason for thinking that an increase in miracles would not necessarily reduce the number of nonbelievers. And even those who claim that they would believe if they witnessed a miracle might be mistaken about that (O’Connell 2013). Ultimately, these “local” arguments seem unlikely on their own to demonstrate that the existence of nonresistant nonbelief does not obtain (or even that it is unlikely to obtain). But what they might demonstrate is that some self-professed nonresistant nonbelievers may require more than just additional evidence in order to come to a belief in God; one impediment could plausibly be unrecognized resistance to belief. If this is right, then there are plausibly fewer nonresistant nonbelievers than we might initially think.

An objection of this first sort has also been raised against Jason Marsh’s argument from “natural nonbelief”. Recall that Marsh claimed that prehistoric humans were “natural nonbelievers”, which means that they had no opportunity for a personal relationship with God because they lacked the very concept of not just monotheism, but also any “theistic-like” belief that posited a “high god”. Matthew Braddock questions Marsh’s claim that there really was overwhelming natural nonbelief amongst prehistoric human beings. As just one of several critiques of Marsh’s support for that claim, Braddock notes that the findings of cognitive science of religion suggest that humans are predisposed to several different supernatural beliefs which, taken together, could plausibly lead one to believe in a high god. So rather than providing evidence that prehistoric humans were natural nonbelievers, cognitive science of religion seems to provide evidence that many of them might not have been (Braddock, 2022).

b. Personal Relationship with God does not Require Belief that God Exists

Another relatively common type of response to Schellenberg-style hiddenness arguments involves the claim that one can enjoy a positively meaningful personal relationship with God even without the explicit belief that God exists. The idea here is to undercut Schellenberg’s reason for thinking that God would ensure that there are no nonresistant nonbelievers. Schellenberg’s stated reason is that God would do what He could to ensure that all capable persons can participate in a positively meaningful conscious relationship with God. Since Schellenberg claims that the belief that God exists is necessary for such a relationship, God would therefore do what He could to eliminate nonbelief in God. And this means that the only nonbelievers would be resistant. But, as some have objected, if belief in God is not necessary for such relationship, then God will not necessarily do what He can to eliminate all nonresistant nonbelief.

There’s an important distinction to make between conscious and nonconscious relationships. Conscious relationships involve an awareness of the relationship, while nonconscious relationships (if they are possible) involve no awareness of the relationship. Schellenberg’s focus is on conscious relationships specifically. He thinks that God would do what He could to ensure that all capable creatures can participate in a conscious relationship with God (that is positively meaningful). And so, because a conscious relationship with God involves an awareness of that relationship, Schellenberg thinks that it necessarily follows that such a relationship with God involves the belief that God exists (Schellenberg 2007).

We can therefore identify two kinds of responses that attempt to argue that personal relationships with God do not require the belief that God exists. One type of response focuses on conscious relationships, and the other type of response focuses on nonconscious relationships. These two types of responses will be discussed in that order.

The first type of response attempts to demonstrate that conscious personal relationships with God do not require the belief that God exists. This type directly denies Schellenberg’s premise that states that such relationships do require the belief that God exists, and so if such a response succeeds, it demonstrates that Schellenberg’s argument (as stated) is unsound. Call these “conscious” responses.

The second type of response attempts to demonstrate that a nonconscious personal relationship with God is possible and that it does not require the belief that God exists. This type does not directly contradict Schellenberg’s premise. Responses of this type, therefore, require an argument (or an assumption) that a nonconscious relationship with God is not relevantly different from a conscious relationship (or that, if there is a relevant difference, that difference can somehow be made up for), and so God would not necessarily ensure that a conscious relationship with Him is possible for every capable person. A nonconscious relationship will do fine. Call these responses “nonconscious” responses.

Some authors have proposed conscious responses. Andrew Cullison, for example, describes a hypothetical case in which two people—Bob and Julie—develop a romantic relationship online. They have long personal discussions, encourage and comfort each other, and generally engage in activities indicative of friendship and romantic relationships. But upon learning that sophisticated computer programs can simulate human conversation so well that humans cannot tell the difference between the program and a real person, Bob begins to doubt that Julie exists, and his doubt becomes strong enough that he no longer feels justified in the belief that she exists. Despite lacking belief, he holds out hope that she exists and decides to keep continuing his interactions with her. Ultimately it turns out that Julie does exist, and it seems that Bob and Julie were able to have a personal relationship with each other despite Bob failing to believe that she exists. Cullison further reasons that if this can be true of two humans, then it can also be true for divine-human relationships (Cullison 2010). Ted Poston and Trent Dougherty defend a similar argument. They maintain that even a person with low confidence (well below full belief) in the existence of another might have a meaningful, personal relationship with that other person. And this may be so even if one person has no idea who that other person might be—they can only identify them by their interactions. They provide an example of two prisoners tapping back and forth on a shared prison wall. For all the prisoners know, they might be hallucinating or mistakenly identifying random patterns as purposeful and caused by another person. So, neither prisoner is certain that the other person exists, or even who that person might be, and yet Poston and Dougherty suggest that they plausibly share in a personal relationship (Dougherty and Poston 2007).

In both Cullison’s example and Poston and Dougherty’s example, the person who lacks belief is at least aware that they might be personally relating to someone else. Thus, their arguments attempt to establish that conscious personal relationships with God are possible without (full) belief that God exists. Terence Cuneo, on the other hand, argues that a personal relationship with God might be possible even for those who are entirely unaware of that relationship. Thus, Cuneo’s argument is that nonconscious personal relationships with God are possible even without the belief that God exists. Cuneo argues that the vitally important elements of divine-human relationships don’t rely on the belief that God exists. His argument relies on understanding God as importantly different from created persons. So, for example, we can unknowingly experience God through our experience of the world, unlike with humans. And there are also actions we can do in the world towards other created persons which can count as being done towards God. For example, the Bible claims that doing good towards other created people can constitute doing good towards God (see Matthew 25:34-40). If we can experience God through the world, and if we can do good towards God by doing good to others, then there is a kind of reciprocal relationship that at least parallels positively meaningful personal relationships. Cuneo argues that one might relate to God in ways like this without any awareness of God, and without any awareness that one might be relating to God. And, if this is so, then one might have a nonconscious relationship with God without any belief that God exists (or even that God might exist) (Cuneo 2013).

c. Greater Goods and Other Reasons God Might Hide

The most common strategy for responding to arguments from divine hiddenness is to argue that there is some reason God allows nonresistant nonbelief (or whatever nonbelief phenomenon is in question). Usually, this involves identifying some good thing that God wants to bring about, but which He cannot bring about without also bringing about (or risking) an undesirable nonbelief phenomenon. But there are also responses that cite a negative state of affairs that God wants to prevent as God’s reason for allowing such nonbelief. These responses argue that such negative states of affairs cannot be prevented (or cannot be guaranteed to be prevented) without allowing some undesirable nonbelief phenomenon. There are also responses which cite neither a greater good nor a prevented evil as God’s reason for allowing an undesirable nonbelief phenomenon.

The first category of proposed reasons for God’s hiddenness is composed of “greater goods” responses. The first question one might ask regarding the notion of a greater goods response is, “greater than what?”. This isn’t always addressed each time an author proposes a greater goods response, but plausibly the good for the sake of which God might allow nonbelief of some kind should be greater than the total of the lost value and the negative value caused by the nonbelief phenomenon in question. The lost value might include the missed opportunity for a meaningfully positive conscious relationship with God during each nonbeliever’s period of nonbelief (at least for Schellenberg-style hiddenness arguments), and the negative value could include any psychological pain experienced by nonbelievers who want to believe.

Depending on one’s view of God’s foreknowledge, it may not be a simple case of weighing lost and negative value against the positive value of the greater good. If one is an open theist, for example, then one will instead have to determine the probability of the greater good occurring if God allows for its possibility, and weigh that against the risk of nonbelief that comes with God allowing for the possibility of that greater good, in order to determine the expected value of God trying to bring about the greater good. For simplicity, the following will discuss greater goods responses under the assumption that God has perfect foreknowledge.

But if the value of the good must outweigh the value of the sum of the lost value and negative value of the nonbelief phenomenon, there is a potential problem. One might wonder if there could even possibly be a greater good. This problem is particularly relevant to Schellenberg-style hiddenness arguments. Schellenberg argues that plausibly there could not be any greater goods. A positively meaningful conscious relationship with God would be the greatest good for created persons (Schellenberg 2007). And so, one might think that greater goods responses must fail in principle; one doesn’t have to analyze the details of a greater goods response to know whether it fails. It fails just by virtue of being a greater goods response. Luke Teeninga attempts to address this problem, arguing that a lesser good, even at the temporary expense of a greater good, may actually lead to more value overall (Teeninga 2020). Nevertheless, most authors do not address the question of whether there could even possibly be a good great enough to justify God in allowing nonresistant nonbelief, and instead just attempt to propose such a good (or at least a good that constitutes part of God’s reason).

Several goods have been proposed as the reason (or part of the reason) that God allows undesirable nonbelief phenomena. One such good is morally significant free will. The idea here is that the greater awareness one has of God, the greater the motivation one has to act rightly (due to a desire to please God, a fear of punishment for doing wrong, and so forth), and therefore if God were too obvious, we would have such a strong motivation to do good that it would cease to be a true choice. This has been defended by Richard Swinburne (1998). Helen De Cruz also addresses this question, examining it through the lens of cognitive science of religion. She suggests that there is some empirical evidence for the claim that a conscious awareness of God heightens one’s motivation to do good (De Cruz 2016).

A similar idea to Swinburne’s can be found in John Hick’s “soul-making theodicy”, which is primarily presented as a general response to the problem of evil. Hick argues that in order to experience the highest goods possible for created beings (including the deepest kind of personal relationship with God), humans must begin in an imperfect state and, through moral striving, develop virtuous characters. Hick’s idea connects to hiddenness because part of the imperfect state that Hick describes necessarily involves being at an “epistemic distance” from God because, as with Swinburne, Hick argues that such epistemic distance is necessary to allow for the capacity for genuine moral choice that is necessary for the development of virtue (Hick 1966).

Richard Swinburne proposes other goods, including the opportunity to find out for oneself whether there is a God and the opportunity for believers to help nonbelievers to come to believe in God (Swinburne 1998). In both cases, it seems there must be nonbelief of some kind to begin with in order for these goods to be possible. Travis Dumsday builds on the latter response (which has become known as the “responsibility” response) and suggests that a believer’s friendship with God is greatly benefited if they can together pursue joint aims. Bringing knowledge of God to others is one such aim (Dumsday 2010a). But of course, this joint aim is impossible if there are no nonbelievers. Dustin Crummett expands on the responsibility response further, noting that communities can be responsible for fostering an atmosphere where individuals within or near to that community are more likely to experience God’s presence (or, conversely, by neglecting our duties, we can create an atmosphere where individuals are less likely to experience God’s presence). These duties go beyond direct evangelization through natural theology or preaching the gospel, and include acts such as encouraging one another in prayer, joining together in collective worship, doing good deeds, and building one another up (Crummett 2015).

Another good often cited as a reason God might allow nonbelief is an increased longing for God (for example, Sarah Coakley 2016 and Robert Lehe 2004). Some authors suggest that spiritual maturity can sometimes require God to hide Himself. A temporary period of God’s hiddenness from us may increase the longing we have for God, which may ultimately be necessary to grow deeper in our relationship with Him.

Several other authors have proposed goods apart from those listed. Aaron Cobb suggests that God hides to increase the opportunity to practice the virtue of hope (Cobb 2017). Travis Dumsday suggests that salvation itself may require God to make Himself less obvious, if salvation requires faith, since plausibly faith requires at least enough doubt to make nonbelief warranted (Dumsday 2015). Andrew Cullison argues that the opportunity for acts of genuine self-sacrifice may naturally result in nonresistant nonbelief, since, in a world where everyone is psychologically certain that a perfectly just God exists, everyone would know that God would compensate us in the afterlife if we sacrificed our lives for the sake of others. Genuine self-sacrifice, Cullison argues, requires that the world contains enough room to doubt God’s existence so that there is enough room for one to think that one truly is accepting the end of one’s own consciousness for eternity when one dies to save another (Cullison 2010). Kirk Lougheed connects the hiddenness literature to the literature on the axiology of theism (the question of what value, lack of value, or negative value might exist due to God’s existence or nonexistence) by arguing that the experience of many of the goods that “antitheists” claim would come from the nonexistence of God (such as privacy, independence, and autonomy) can actually obtain if God exists but hides (Lougheed 2018).

Some authors also propose greater goods responses that specifically apply to hiddenness arguments apart from Schellenberg’s. Max Baker-Hytch, in response to Stephen Maitzen’s demographics of theism argument, suggests that one good thing God wants is for humans to be mutually epistemically dependent on one another. That is, God wants us to rely on each other for our knowledge. Baker-Hytch argues that if mutual epistemic dependence is a good God wants, then it would be no surprise that there is an uneven distribution of theism, both geographically and temporally. In a world where we rely on each other for knowledge, but people are separated from each other geographically and temporally, what one group tends to believe may very likely not reach another group (Baker-Hytch 2016). Kevin Vandergriff proposes a good as a response to Jason Marsh’s argument from natural nonbelief. He suggests that natural nonbelievers, who had no opportunity for belief in God, had instead an opportunity to enjoy particularly unique kinds of meaningfulness. For example, natural nonbelievers had the opportunity to be part of what enabled later humans to relate to God. The idea is that religious concepts developed over time to eventually give rise to theism as understood today, and that natural nonbelievers had the opportunity to contribute to that development, which is in itself a meaningful role to play in history (Vandergriff 2016).

After greater goods responses, the most common type of reason proposed for why God might allow undesirable nonbelief phenomena is that God does so in order to prevent some negative state of affairs. Strictly speaking, these can all be thought of as greater goods responses as well, because in each case God could prevent the evil in question by withholding some good or another (for example, free will) or, in the most extreme case, God could prevent the evil in question by creating nothing at all. Several reasons proposed of this sort suggest that God hides from some people to prevent those people from making morally sub-optimal responses of one sort or another upon learning that God exists.

There are several kinds of morally sub-optimal response God might want to prevent. To start off, despite their nonresistance while nonbelievers, some nonresistant nonbelievers may nevertheless reject God upon learning of His existence and grasping a full understanding of who He is and what acceptance of Him means for their lives (See Dumsday 2010b and Howard-Snyder 1996 and 2016). Others might accept God but for the wrong reasons—for their own benefit, for example, rather than for His own sake. And even those who accept God for the right reasons might not do so due to their own moral merit (Howard-Snyder 1996 and 2016). God might also want to prevent some people from resenting Him due to the evil they see or experience in the world (Dumsday 2012a). He might also be motivated to prevent people from using the experience of God merely as a drug, rather than attempting to foster a real loving relationship with God (Dumsday 2014b). God might also care about human beings fostering their personal relationships with other created persons, and thus in some cases He might hide to prevent some people from neglecting those relationships due to a sole focus on God (Dumsday 2018).

There are other proposed negative states of affairs God might want to prevent by hiding that do not fit neatly into the previous category. For example, Michael J. Murray suggests that God hides because, if His existence were too obvious, created persons would be coerced into following God, and God wants to prevent this (Murray 1993). Travis Dumsday argues that one who sins with knowledge of God’s existence is more culpable than one who sins without knowledge of God’s existence, and so God might hide to prevent certain people from gaining more moral culpability (Dumsday 2012b). Dumsday suggests that God might also hide for the benefit of resistant nonbelievers. If God made Himself known to all nonresistant nonbelievers, then that could constitute evidence for God’s existence to the resistant nonbelievers, who may respond by doubling-down in their resistance (or they may respond in other undesirable ways, such as acting in morally bad ways to spite God). God thus hides to prevent this negative state of affairs, and so that he can work in the hearts of the resistant until they are ready to accept His revelation of Himself.

It is important to note that most (if not all) of the negative states of affairs proposed as reasons God might hide could be prevented by God removing human free will. Schellenberg has argued elsewhere that God would not create human free will (of this kind) precisely because of all of the negative states of affairs that it makes possible (Schellenberg 2004). Nevertheless, it remains a standard practice in the literature on the problem of divine hiddenness to appeal to free will of the kind that risks such negative states of affairs.

In addition to greater goods God wants to bring about, and negative states of affairs God wants to prevent, there are other reasons proposed as the explanation (or part of the explanation) for why God allows undesirable nonbelief phenomena. Paul Moser suggests that propositional knowledge of God’s existence does no good in bringing created persons closer to a personal relationship with God. Thus, God instead works to ready a person’s will to accept a relationship with Him, rather than working with their minds to accept belief that He exists (Moser 2014). Ebrahim Azadegan appeals to a similar idea, arguing that, if God’s love includes eros (the kind of love typical of intimate relationships) then created persons must be more than merely nonresistant to engage in a personal relationship with God; they must also act (for example, repent, pray, reflect on revelation). And so, God must work on people’s hearts, not their minds (Azadegan 2014). In order for their arguments to succeed, Moser and Azadegan must both assume that all apparently nonresistant nonbelievers (even any who may also be actual nonresistant nonbelievers) would not accept a relationship with God upon learning of His existence and that their current lack of a personal relationship with God is, in fact, a heart issue (even though, in some cases, they would not be accurately described as “resistant” to a relationship with God), rather than an issue of propositional knowledge.

The final kind of reason to discuss that is cited as an explanation for why God might allow undesirable nonbelief phenomena is that some of God’s other attributes might explain God’s motivation for allowing those nonbelief phenomena. For example, Travis Dumsday suggests that God’s justice may be what explains divine hiddenness, rather than His love. According to Dumsday, we may not deserve knowledge of God’s existence, and so that is why God does not do more to reveal Himself to us. While Schellenberg thinks that, in this case, God’s love should bring Him to offer us more than what we deserve, Dumsday thinks that this prioritizes God’s love over His justice and that we can’t be so certain that love would always trump justice (Dumsday 2014).

Michael Rea also argues that God’s other attributes may explain why God does not make His existence more obvious to everyone. Rea appeals to God’s personality. It may be possible that God has a distinct personality, and furthermore it may be very good for God to act in alignment with that personality. Rea says that what we think of as divine hiddenness may actually be better characterized as divine silence. According to Rea, God may be justified in remaining “silent” if doing so is in accordance with his personality, so long as He provides other ways of experiencing God’s presence. Rea thinks God has done this by providing us with Liturgy (especially taking the eucharist) and with the biblical narrative (Rea 2009).

d. Other Responses

There are other kinds of responses to hiddenness arguments that do not fit neatly into the previous categories. The first of these, which was borrowed from the literature on the problem of evil, is “skeptical theism”. Like the previous category of responses, skeptical theism does suggest that God may have a reason (or reasons) for remaining hidden, but, unlike the previous category, skeptical theism does not claim to know what that reason (or those reasons) are (or even what they might be). Skeptical theists argue that no one is in a position to know whether God has or doesn’t have any reasons for allowing nonresistant nonbelief. And so long as, for all we know, God might have a reason, we cannot conclude that the existence of nonresistant nonbelief is strong evidence against God’s existence (McBrayer and Swenson 2012).

One final kind of response claims, contra Schellenberg, that divine love does not entail that God would be open to a personal relationship with all created persons at all times. These sorts of arguments attempt to respond specifically to Schellenberg-style hiddenness arguments. Michael Rea, for example, argues that Schellenberg’s understanding of divine love, which is heavily analogous to human parental love, is mistaken, and pays very little attention to the ways many theologians have understood divine love throughout history. God is, according to the tradition, completely transcendent, and beyond human comprehension. Divine love must be understood in this light, and thus Rea argues that human parent-child relationships are a bad analogy for the kind of relationship a created person might have with God. And so, he concludes that God would not always be open to a relationship with every created person, at all times, if “relationship” is understood how Schellenberg understands it (Rea 2016).

Ebrahim Azadegan also employs the idea that God’s love might not entail openness to a personal relationship for all created persons, at all times. He frames it in terms of a dilemma: either God’s love is pure “agape” (benevolent love) or it also includes “eros” (the kind of love typical in intimate relationships). As mentioned previously, Azadegan thinks that created persons must be much more than merely nonresistant in order to be ready for personal relationship with God if God’s love includes eros. But if God’s love is purely agape, then there is no room for personal relationship with God. God, in that case, would be a purely benevolent giver, with no need for reciprocal relationship (Azadegan 2014).

3. Divine Hiddenness and Specific Faith Traditions

While Schellenberg intends his argument to apply to any being who could rightly be called “God”, most of the literature regarding hiddenness arguments concerns itself with a more-or-less Christian understanding of God, whether implicitly or explicitly. But some authors have tried to address what other faith traditions might say when faced with hiddenness arguments.

Jerome Gellman argues that, in certain understandings of Judaism, God is explicitly understood as hidden by His very nature. He is utterly inaccessible to created persons, and all we can do is yearn for God. Thus, God’s hiddenness is built into the very concept of God (Gellman 2016).

Jon McGinnis looks at hiddenness from the perspective of medieval Muslim philosophers. He argues that Schellenberg’s arguments don’t apply to God as understood in the Islamic tradition. “Love” is not a perfection, according to Islam. And insofar as God might be loving, God is both lover and beloved. “Personal relationship” with created persons would not be sought by God, since there is no relevant sense in which God is a person, nor is there a relevant sense in which God can relate to created persons (McGinnis 2016).

Nick Trakakis addresses the hiddenness argument from the perspective of several eastern religions, including Eastern Orthodox Christianity, Islam, and Hinduism. He argues, like Michael Rea, that western philosophers anthropomorphize God, assuming His attributes are comparable to human attributes. But in eastern religion, God is incomprehensible. He is not merely one being amongst other beings; He is utterly different from created beings. One implication here is that, according to these religious traditions, we can’t understand “personal relationship” with God in the sense Schellenberg uses in his argument (Trakakis 2016).

4. Other Problems of Divine Hiddenness

While the “argument from divine hiddenness” refers to a family of arguments for atheism, that term is sometimes used interchangeably with the term “problem of divine hiddenness”. But the “problem of divine hiddenness” may refer to a much broader range of concerns than what has been covered above. Mirroring what is often said about the “problem of evil”, we might identify “theological” and “experiential” problems of divine hiddenness, in addition to the “philosophical” problem that has been the focus above.

“Theological” problems of divine hiddenness differ from philosophical problems in that they are not posed as arguments against God’s existence, but instead as puzzles that need to be solved, usually with the assumption that there is a theistic solution. Until the late 20^th century, when philosophers such as Schellenberg and Drange started rigorously defending hiddenness as an argument for atheism, the historical approach to the topic of hiddenness had primarily been approached as a theological (or experiential) problem. St. Anselm of Canterbury expresses a theological problem when he writes, “But if you are everywhere, why do I not see you, since you are present?” (Anselm trans. 1995). While there is significant overlap between the theological and philosophical problems of divine hiddenness, one reason for considering them distinct problems is that theological problems would not necessarily be solved just by determining that atheistic hiddenness arguments fail to establish the truth of atheism. One who is concerned with the theological problem of divine hiddenness wants to know why God is (or at least seems to be) hidden from some people. And thus, for example, the skeptical theist response (that we are not in a position to know whether God has reason to remain hidden) is not satisfying to one who is interested in the theological problem of divine hiddenness. Even if it turns out that skeptical theism solves the philosophical problem of divine hiddenness, it plausibly cannot solve the theological problem of divine hiddenness. Nevertheless, many of the ideas considered regarding the philosophical problem are relevant to the theological problem. Consider, for example, responses that aim to propose a good for the sake of which God would be willing to hide. These would plausibly also be relevant to the theological problem.

Compared to theological problems, experiential problems of divine hiddenness almost certainly overlap much less with matters relevant to philosophical problems of divine hiddenness. An “experiential” problem is the lived experience of someone to whom God seems hidden. It includes the unmet desire, and any suffering, that results from failing to know or experience God or God’s presence. Although some of those who feel that God is hidden from them may find some degree of comfort in considering certain responses to the philosophical problem of divine hiddenness (if they judge that any responses are plausible), for the most part, such responses are irrelevant to help ease the difficulty of their experiences of hiddenness.

While some might think that philosophy is impotent to address experiential problems of divine hiddenness, some philosophers, including Yujin Nagasawa (2016) and Ian DeWeese-Boyd (2016), have nevertheless attempted to address experiential problems.

5. References and Further Reading

• Anderson, Charity and Jeffrey Sanford Russel. “Divine Hiddenness and Other Evidence.” Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion 10 (2021),
  • Discusses evidential arguments from divine hiddenness, and responds to two kinds of objections to such arguments, suggesting that both objections fail to demonstrate that hiddenness has no evidential bearing on the existence of God.
• Andrews, M. “Divine Hiddenness and Affective Forecasting.” Res Cogitans 5(1) (2014): 102-110.
  • Argues, by appealing to psychological data, that humans are bad at predicting how we would respond to confronting evidence of God’s existence.
• Anselm. Proslogion. Translated by Thomas Williams. Hackett Publishing Company, 1995.
  • Features a historical example of a hiddenness sentiment being expressed.
• Azadegan, Ebrahim. “Divine Hiddenness and Human Sin: The Noetic Effects of Sin,” Journal of Reformed Theology 7(1) (2013): 69-90.
  • Argues that there is no inculpable nonbelief, because Sin affects the cognitive faculty.
• Azadegan, Ebrahim. “Divine Love and the Argument from Divine Hiddenness.” European Journal for the Philosophy of Religion 6(2) (2014): 101-116.
  • Argues that Divine Love does not entail that God would ensure there are no nonresistant nonbelievers.
• Baker-Hytch, Max. “Mutual Epistemic Dependence and the Demographic Divine Hiddenness Problem.” Religious Studies 52(3) (2016): 375-394.
  • Responds to Stephen Maitzen’s “demographics of theism” argument, arguing that the actual distribution of theism is to be expected on theism if God wants humans to be mutually epistemically dependent on each other.
• Braddock, Matthew. “Natural Nonbelief in God: Prehistoric Humans, Divine Hiddenness, and Debunking.” In Evolutionary Debunking Arguments: Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, Philosophy of Mathematics, Metaphysics, and Epistemology, edited by Diego Machuca. Routledge, 2022.
  • Responds to Jason Marsh’s “natural nonbelief” argument, undercutting Marsh’s support for the claim that prehistoric humans were natural nonbelievers.
• Coakley, Sarah. “Divine Hiddenness or Dark Intimacy? How John of the Cross Dissolves a Contemporary Philosophical Dilemma.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Adam Green and Eleonore Stump, 229-245. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Argues that Divine Hiddenness is actually a unique way that God reveals Himself to us.
• Cobb, Aaron. “The Silence of God and the Theological Virtue of Hope.” Res Philosophica 94(1) (2017): 23-41.
  • Argues that God may remain silent to make space for humans to cultivate the virtue of hope.
• Crummett, Dustin. “’We Are Here to Help Each Other’: Religious Community, Divine Hiddenness, and the Responsibility Argument.” Faith and Philosophy 32(1) (2015): 45-62.
  • Builds on the “responsibility argument” developed by Richard Swinburne by noting additional responsibilities humans and faith communities have towards each other that influence individuals’ dispositions to believe in God.
• Cullison, Andrew. “Two Solutions to the Problem of Divine Hiddenness.” American Philosophical Quarterly 47(2) (2010): 119-134.
  • Argues that personal relationship with God is possible even if one lacks belief that God exists, and proposes that one benefit of divine hiddenness is the possibility for genuine self-sacrifice.
• Cuneo, Terence. “Another Look at Divine Hiddenness.” Religious Studies 49 (2013): 151-164.
  • Argues that the vitally important elements of divine-human relationships don’t rely on believing at all times that God exists.
• De Cruz, Helen. “Divine Hiddenness and the Cognitive Science of Religion.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 53-68. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Analyzes certain responses to hiddenness arguments through the lens of Cognitive Science of Religion.
• DeWeese-Boyd, Ian. “Lyric Theodicy: Gerard Manley Hopkins and the Problem of Existential Hiddenness.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Adam Green and Eleonore Stump, 260-277. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Addresses the existential problem of divine hiddenness by looking at the poetry of G.M. Hopkins.
• Dougherty, Trent, and Ted Poston. “Divine Hiddenness and the Nature of Belief.” Religious Studies 43 (2007): 183-196.
  • Argues that relationship with God might be possible (for a time) with merely partial, de re belief that God exists.
• Drange, Theodore. “The Argument from Non-Belief.” Religious Studies 29 (1993): 417-432.
  • Argues that the God of evangelical Biblical Christianity is unlikely to exist given the prevalence of nonbelief.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness and the Responsibility Argument: Assessing Schellenberg’s Argument against Theism.” Philosophia Christi 12(2) (2010a): 357-371.
  • Argues that God might hide in order to make deeper relationships possible with some created persons, by providing them the opportunity to work alongside God to share news of Him with other created persons.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness, Free Will, and the Victims of Wrongdoing.” Faith and Philosophy 27(4) (2010b): 423-438.
  • Argues that God might hide to protect victims of suffering from reacting sub-optimally to knowledge of God’s existence.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness and Creaturely Resentment.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 72 (2012a) 41-51.
  • Argues that God might hide to prevent some created persons from resenting God’s greatness.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness as Divine Mercy.” Religious Studies 48(2) (2012b): 183-198.
  • Argues that God hides out of mercy, since we gain greater culpability if we sin with knowledge of God.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness as Deserved.” Faith and Philosophy 31 (2014): 286-302.
  • Argues that God might hide as an expression of His perfect justice, given that we do not deserve knowledge of God’s existence.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness and Special Revelation.” Religious Studies 51(2) (2015): 241-259.
  • Argues that God might hide to make possible salvation through faith.
• Dumsday, Travis. “Divine Hiddenness and Alienation.” Heythrop Journal 59(3) (2018): 433-447.
  • Argues that God may hide so that we do not neglect our relationships with other humans.
• Gellman, “The Hidden God of the Jews: Hegel, Reb Nachman, and the Aqedah.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 175-191. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Approaches hiddenness from the perspective of Jewish authors, some of whom embrace God as essentially hidden.
• Henry, Douglas. “Does Reasonable Nonbelief Exist?” Faith and Philosophy 18(1) (2001): 74-92.
  • Argues that reasonable nonbelief plausibly does not exist.
• Hick, John. Evil and the God of Love. Macmillan, 1966.
  • As part of his general theodicy against evil, Hick argues that humans need to start out in a state that involves a certain epistemic distance from God.
• Howard-Snyder, Daniel. “The Argument from Divine Hiddenness.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 26(3) (1996): 433-453.
  • Argues that God hides to prevent created persons from reacting inappropriately in one way or another to knowledge of God’s existence.
• Howard-Snyder, Daniel. “Divine Openness and Creaturely Non-Resistant Non-Belief.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 126-138. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Continues to build on his 1996 argument and defend it against various criticisms.
• Janzen, Greg. “Is God’s belief requirement Rational?” Religious studies 47 (2011) 465-478.
  • Argues that the existence of nonbelief is evidence against any kind of theism that requires belief in God for salvation.
• Lehe, Robert. “A Response to the Argument from the Reasonableness of Nonbelief.” Faith and Philosophy 21(2) (2004) 159-174.
  • Argues that God might hide to intensify one’s longing for God, and thus make one more likely to embrace a personal relationship with God upon revelation of His existence.
• Lougheed. Kirk. “The Axiological Solution to Divine Hiddenness.” Ratio 31(3) (2018): 331-341.
  • Argues that the experiences of several goods claimed by anti-theists to require atheism are possible even if God exists, so long as He hides.
• Maitzen, Stephen. “Divine Hiddenness and the Demographics of Theism.” Religious 219 Studies 42 (2006): 177-191.
  • Argues that the actually temporal and geographic distribution of theism is more expected on naturalism than on theism, and so that distribution provides evidence for naturalism and against theism.
• Marsh, Jason. “Darwin and the Problem of Natural Nonbelief.” The Monist 96 (2013): 349-376.
  • Argues that the existence of early human nonbelief, prior to the advent of monotheism, is more probable on atheism than theism, and so this kind of nonbelief provides evidence for atheism and against theism.
• McBrayer, Justin P., and Philip Swenson, “Scepticism about the Argument from Divine Hiddenness.” Religious Studies 48(2) (2012): 129-150.
  • Argues that we are not in a position to know whether there is any good reason for the existence of nonresistant nonbelief, and so the existence of nonresistant nonbelief is not evidence against theism.
• McGinnis, Jon. “The Hiddenness of ‘Divine Hiddenness’: Divine Love in Medieval Islamic Lands.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 157-174. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Argues that the assumptions made by Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument do not apply to Islam.
• Moser, Paul. “The Virtue of Friendship with God.” In Religious Faith and Intellectual Virtue, edited by L.F. Callahan and Timothy O’Connor, 140-156. New York: Oxford University Press, 2014.
  • Argues that faith, as friendship with God, has an irreducible volitional component, and thus God is not motivated to provide humans with mere propositional belief in God’s existence.
• Murray, Michael J. “Coercion and the Hiddenness of God.” American Philosophical Quarterly 30(1) (1993): 27-38.
  • Argues that God hides because full revelation of God’s existence to created persons might constitute a kind of coercion.
• Nagasawa, Yujin. “Silence, Evil, and Shusaku Endo.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 246-259. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Suggests a kind of response to the experiential problem of hiddenness.
• Nemoianu, V.M. “Pascal on Divine Hiddenness.” International Philosophical Quarterly 55(3) (2015): 325-343.
  • Discusses Divine Hiddenness through the lens of Blaise Pascal.
• O’Connell, Jake. “Divine Hiddenness: Would More Miracles Solve the Problem?” Heythrop Journal 54 (2013) 261-267.
  • Argues that there’s a high probability that many people would not believe in God even if there were significantly more miracles.
• Rea, Michael. “Narrative, Liturgy, and the Hiddenness of God.” In Metaphysics and God: Essays in Honor of Eleonore Stump, edited by Kevin Timpe and Eleonore Stump, 76-96. New York: Rutledge, 2009.
  • Argues that God would be justified in remaining silent so long as it is in accordance with His personality, and He provides a widely accessible way to experience His presence.
• Rea, Michael. “Hiddenness and Transcendence.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 210-226. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Argues that Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument relies on assumptions about Divine Love not shared by much of the tradition of Christian theology.
• Schellenberg, J.L. Divine Hiddenness and Human Reason. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1993.
  • Argues that the existence of reasonable nonbelief is a reason for thinking that God does not exist.
• Schellenberg, J.L. “The Atheist’s Free Will Offence.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 56 (2004): 1-15.
  • Argues that the existence of libertarian free will would provide evidence against God’s existence.
• Schellenberg, J.L. The Wisdom to Doubt. Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press, 2007.
  • See especially chapters 9 and 10. Argues that, if God exists, then all nonbelievers must either be resistant or incapable of a positively meaningful conscious relationship with God
• Swinburne, Richard. Providence and the Problem of Evil. Oxford University Press, 1998.
  • See especially chapter 10. Proposes several reasons God hides.
• Taber, Tyler, and Tyler Dalton McNabb. “Is the Problem of Divine Hiddenness a Problem for the Reformed Epistemologist?” Heythrop Journal 57(6) (2016): 783-793.
  • Argues that divine hiddenness amounts to the problem of sin’s consequences.
• Teeninga, Luke. “Divine Hiddenness and the Problem of No Greater Goods.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 89 (2020): 107-123.
  • Addresses the problem of whether there could possibly be a greater good than that of a conscious personal relationship with God, and thus whether all “greater goods” responses to the hiddenness argument must fail.
• Trakakis, N.N. “The Hidden Divinity and What It Reveals.” In Hidden Divinity and Religious Belief: New Perspectives, edited by Eleonore Stump and Adam Green, 192-209. Cambridge University Press, 2016.
  • Looks at hiddenness from the perspective of eastern philosophies and religions including Eastern Orthodox Christianity, Islam, and Hinduism.
• Vandergriff, Kevin. “Natural Nonbelief as a Necessary Means to a Life of Choiceworthy Meaning.” Open Theology 2(1) (2016): 34-52.
  • Responds to Jason Marsh’s problem of “natural nonbelief”, arguing that nonbelief allowed early humans to have a particular kind of meaningful life not available to modern humans.
• Weidner, Veronika. Examining Schellenberg’s Hiddenness Argument. Springer Verlag, 2018.
  • Provides an in-depth examination of Schellenberg’s hiddenness argument, how its fine details have developed over time, and much of the discussion it has prompted. Weidner also provides an argument that explicit belief in God is not necessary for one to have a personal relationship with God.

 

Author Information

Luke Teeninga
Email: luketeeninga@gmail.com
Tyndale University
Canada