Alan Gewirth (1912-2004)
Alan Gewirth was an American philosopher, famous for his argument that universal human rights can be rationally justified as the outcome of claims necessarily made by rational agents. According to this argument, first outlined in Reason and Morality (1978), all agents necessarily want to be successful in their actions, and since freedom and well-being are the generally necessary conditions of successful agency, every agent must claim rights to freedom and well-being. As the justifying reason for the agent’s rights-claim is the very fact that she is an agent with purposes that she wants to realize, she must also accept the universalized claim that all agents have rights to freedom and well-being. Gewirth calls these rights generic as they correspond to features generically necessary to successful agency. Hence, the supreme principle of morality is the Principle of Generic Consistency (PGC), stating that every agent should act in accord with the generic rights of the recipients of her actionsas well as of herself. While freedom refers to one’s control of one’s behaviour in accordance with one’s own unforced choice, well-being refers to the general conditions needed for one to be able to act and to maintain and expand one’s capacity for successful agency.
The PGC applies not only to interpersonal actions but also to social and political morality as it justifies rules and institutions needed for the protection of the generic rights to freedom and well-being at the level of political communities. The minimal state, preventing violations of basic rights, as well as the democratic state, upholding the right to freedom at the political level, are justified in this way. In The Community of Rights (1996), Gewirth argues that the PGC also justifies a more supportive state, involving rights to economic democracy and to productive agency as further specifications of the generic rights to freedom and well-being.
In his last published work Self-Fulfillment (1998), Gewirth outlines a normative theory of self-fulfilment based on a distinction between aspiration-fulfilment and capacity-fulfilment. In aspiration-fulfilment, one’s aim is to satisfy one’s deepest desires; in capacity-fulfilment it is to make the best of oneself. While one’s deepest desires might be for goals that are unrealistic or even immoral, trying to make the best of oneself requires that one’s goals and aspirations are consistent with the requirements of reason. Thus, capacity-fulfilment involves making the most effective possible use of one’s freedom and well-being within the limits set by the PGC as the rationally justified supreme principle of morality.
Beginning with an analysis of the normative claims involved in agency, Gewirth manages not only to justify a supreme moral principle, but also to derive implications of that principle for political and personal morality. His work is not only a major contribution to contemporary moral philosophy, but also an impressive example of how philosophy can make sense of our lives as agents who are rationally committed to morality.
Table of Contents
- Life
- Gewirth in the Context of Twentieth Century Moral Philosophy
- Gewirth’s Moral Theory: Agency, Reason, and the Principle of Generic Consistency
- The Community of Rights
- The Good Life of Agents
- References and Further Reading
1. Life
Alan Gewirth was born in Union City, New Jersey, on November 28, 1912 as Isidore Gewirtz. His parents, Hyman Gewirtz and Rose Lees Gewirtz, were immigrants from what was then Tsarist Russia, where the antisemitic pogroms of the early twentieth century forced many people to cross the Atlantic in the hope of a new beginning and a better life for themselves. Gewirth later dedicated his 1982 book Human Rights “To the memory of my Mother and Father and to Aunt Rebecca and Cousin Libby who as young emigrants from Czarist Russia knew the importance of human rights.” At age eleven, after having been teased by playmates on the schoolyard as “Dizzy Izzy,” he announced to his parents that from now on his first name was to be Alan. The source of inspiration here was a character, Alan Breck Stewart, in Robert Louis Stevenson’s historical adventure novel Kidnapped. In the novel, Alan Breck Stewart was an eighteenth-century Scottish Jacobite whom the young boy Isidore Gewirtz admired as a fearless man of the people. Later, in 1942, he changed his last name from Gewirtz to Gewirth. At a time when antisemitism was also rife in the US, many Jewish Americans found it necessary to anglicize their names. In this way Isidore Gewirtz became Alan Gewirth.
His father, who once had entertained a dream of becoming a concert violinist, gave him violin lessons when Alan was just four or five years old, and later had him take professional lessons. At around age eleven or twelve, Alan himself started to give violin lessons to younger children in the family’s apartment. After entering Columbia University in 1930, he joined the Columbia University Orchestra as a violinist, becoming concertmaster in 1934.
At Columbia, Gewirth was encouraged to pursue philosophical studies by his teacher Richard McKeon. In 1937, he became McKeon’s research assistant at the University of Chicago. Gewirth served in the US Army 1942-46, moving up the ranks from private to captain, after which time he spent the 1946-47 academic year at Columbia on the GI Bill, completing his doctorate in philosophy with a dissertation on Marsilius of Padua and medieval political philosophy (published as a book in 1951). From 1947 onwards, he was a regular member of the faculty of the University of Chicago, from 1960 as a full professor of philosophy. Gewirth was elected a Fellow of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences in 1975, and served as President of the American Philosophical Association Western Division (1973-74) as well as President of the American Society for Political and Legal Philosophy (1983-84). He was the recipient of several prizes and awards, including the Gordon J. Laing Prize for Reason and Morality. He was appointed the Edward Carson Waller Distinguished Service Professor of Philosophy at the University of Chicago in 1975; he became an Emeritus Professor in 1992.
Gewirth continued to give lectures well into his eighties, teaching a course on the philosophical foundations of human rights within the newly constituted Human Rights Program at the University of Chicago as late as 1997-2000. His last public talk was given in August 2003 at the XXI World Congress of Philosophy in Istanbul, Turkey. Alan Gewirth died on May 9, 2004. He was married three times, between 1942 and 1954 to Janet Adams (1916-1997), from 1956 until her death to Marcella Tilton (1928-1992), and from 1996 to Jean Laves (1936-2018). In his first marriage, he was the father of James Gewirth and Susan Gewirth Kumar; in his second marriage, he was the father of Andrew Gewirth, Daniel Gewirth, and Letitia Rose Gewirth Naigles. His younger brother was the educational psychologist Nathaniel Gage (1917–2008).
2. Gewirth in the Context of Twentieth Century Moral Philosophy
The twentieth century was not a very hospitable age for philosophers trying to provide an objectivist foundation for moral principles. In the first half of the century the dominant mode of philosophical thinking about ethics was emotivist and non-cognitivist. Emotivism regarded moral statements about what is right and wrong as mere expressions of the speaker’s attitudes and of her desire to make us share these attitudes. Like other emotive statements, they could be neither true nor false, and there could be no way of proving them. Moral pronouncements came to be thought of as similar to claims made in advertising or in various forms of propaganda. Taking its point of departure in the works of philosophers such as A. J. Ayer in the U.K. and Charles Leslie Stevenson in the U.S., emotivism maintained a dominant presence in analytic philosophy throughout the Cold War years.
The later years of the twentieth century witnessed the rise of postmodernism and a return of pre-modernist cultural relativism. This created room for moral values in public debate, but these values were regarded as relative to various traditions or cultures. Once again, belief in objective and universally justified moral values, such as human rights, was rejected as a culturally produced superstition. However, there was also the additional suspicion that any talk of universal moral values was in reality a disguised attempt by the specific culture of Western Enlightenment to impersonate global reason. Hence, the discourse of universal human rights could either be dismissed as a form of cultural imperialism or find itself compared with a belief in witches and unicorns. The latter claim was made by Alasdair MacIntyre, one of the leading proponents of a communitarian form of relativism.
Against this rather hostile background, Alan Gewirth took upon himself to prove that there could indeed be given a rational foundation for normative ethics, a foundation that would be valid for all rational agents regardless of their subjective preferences or cultural context. Over a period of twenty years, Gewirth published four books and more than sixty journal articles, developing and defending his argument that we, as rational agents who want to realize our goals, logically must claim rights to freedom and well-being, since these rights are the necessary conditions of all successful action. His theory has been the topic of one large analytical monograph and three edited anthologies of philosophical comments and criticism (see References and Further Readings for details). It continues to receive the attention of human rights scholars, moral philosophers, sociologists, and political scientists, and is likely to have a lasting influence on normative analysis and debate in general.
3. Gewirth’s Moral Theory: Agency, Reason, and the Principle of Generic Consistency
In Reason and Morality (1978), Gewirth described his theory as “a modified naturalism” (Gewirth 1978, 363). He wanted to anchor morality in the empirical world of agents and in the canons of deductive and inductive logic, rather than relegating it to intuitions or emotive attitudes that could be arbitrarily accepted or rejected.
Agency is a natural context for a moral theory given that moral prescriptions are normally about what we should or should not do. Here it could be objected that at least one type of moral theory, virtue ethics, is about what kind of dispositions we should have and so focuses on what we should be like rather than on what we should do. However, virtues are at least implicitly related to agency, as the dispositions that they are meant to cultivate are manifested in the ways virtuous persons act. A prudent person is a person who acts prudently, a courageous person is one who acts courageously, a temperate person is one who acts temperately, and so on. Moreover, a person’s inculcating and developing virtues in herself involves agency – as Aristotle pointed out, one becomes prudent, courageous, and temperate by acting prudently, courageously, and temperately; virtues are acquired by practice and habituation.
a. The Normative Structure of Agency and the Necessary Goods of Agency
Any kind of naturalist normative ethics will face the formidable obstacle known as Hume’s Law, saying that we cannot derive an “ought” from an “is.” According to Hume’s Law, descriptive and prescriptive statements inhabit different logical domains. That is, we cannot derive moral conclusions directly from non-moral empirical premises. For instance, from the descriptive observation that, as a matter of fact, most people in a particular society are in favour of a criminalization of blasphemy, we cannot derive the prescriptive conclusion that blasphemy indeed should be criminalized (in this or in any other society).
However, Gewirth argues that agency provides a context in which it is indeed possible to escape the constraints of Hume’s Law. This is so, since agency in itself has a normative structure involving evaluative and normative judgements made by agents about the very conditions of their agency. Gewirth begins with certain evaluative judgements that necessarily must be made by all rational agents. He then moves dialectically from these judgements to a moral rights-claim that likewise must be embraced by all rational agents. This is to derive moral rights in accordance with the Dialectically Necessary Method. The claim that all agents have rights is therefore presented not as a moral conclusion derived from a non-moral empirical premise about what all agents need, but instead as what rationally consistent agents must accept, given their own necessary evaluative judgements about what it means to be an agent.
To begin with, every agent can be assumed to consider the purpose of her action as something good. Gewirth takes this as a conceptual truth of agency. We involve ourselves in agency for the sake of something that we want to achieve by our action, and in this sense our action reveals a positive evaluation of its purpose. However, for an agent to hold her purpose to be good is not necessarily for her to make a moral evaluation. In this context, “good” should be understood simply as “worth achieving,” according to whatever criteria of worth an agent may have. These criteria need not be moral or even prudent ones. For instance, a burglar might have as his purpose to break into people’s homes and steal their possessions, and a person of a hedonist persuasion might have as his purpose to eat and drink as much as he can, although he is aware that this is bad for his long-term health. Still, the burglar and the hedonist hold their respective purposes to be good in the minimal sense that they want to pursue them; this is why they move from non-action to action with the intention of realizing their purposes.
Hence, agency is purposive and for an agent to have a purpose involves that she holds it to be good. However, agency must also be voluntary, in that the agent must be able to control her behaviour by means of her own unforced choice. It must be her choice to act in a certain way; otherwise, the purposes for which she acts would not be her purposes.
Gewirth’s conceptual analysis thus results in an account of action as being controlled by the agent’s unforced and informed choice (voluntariness) and guided by her intention to realize some goal of hers that she judges to be good (purposivenenss). Voluntariness and purposiveness are the generic features of agency, as they necessarily pertain to all actions.
Having argued that agency involves voluntariness and purposiveness, and that purposiveness involves the agent’s positive evaluation of her goals of action, Gewirth goes on to claim that all agents must hold that the capacities and conditions needed for generally successful agency constitute necessary goods, regardless of their many different particular goals of action. Of course, the capacities and conditions needed for climbing mountains are very different from the capacities and conditions needed for writing a doctoral dissertation in philosophy, not to speak of the capacities and conditions needed for being a good chess player or being good at growing tomatoes. However, common to all agents, including the mountain climber, the dissertation writer, the chess student, and the tomato grower, is the need for certain general capacities and conditions without which it is either impossible or at least unlikely that they will be successful in the realization of any of their purposes. As every agent necessarily wants to be successful in her actions – the very point of her agency being to achieve her purposes – every agent must accept that the capacities and conditions generally needed for any pursuit are necessary goods. They are goods, in the sense of being objects of positive value, and they are necessary, in the sense that no agent can do without them.
According to Gewirth, the necessary goods of agency are freedom and well-being. Freedom and well-being can also be conceptualized as the generic goods of agency, as they correspond to the generic features of agency, voluntariness and purposiveness. Freedom, corresponding to voluntariness, hence refers to the agent’s actual ability to control her behaviour in accordance with her informed and unforced choice. It requires that the agent is not subjected to violence, coercion, and deception in a way that negatively affects her capacity to control her agency. Moreover, it also requires that the agent should not suffer from any compulsive obsession that would interfere with her capacity for informed and unforced choice; nor should she be addicted to drugs that would negatively affect her capacity to control her behaviour. Without freedom, a person’s behaviour would not qualify as agency, as it would not reflect her choices and her will; instead, she would resemble a slave, being the tool of other people, or the powerless victim of uncontrollable impulses.
Well-being, corresponding to purposiveness, refers to the agent’s possession of abilities and resources necessary to her successful realization of her purposes, involving basic preconditions of agency as well as the conditions required for maintaining and developing capacities for agency. The well-being relevant to successful agency therefore has three levels. Basic well-being includes life, health, physical integrity, and mental equilibrium, as well as objects necessary to maintain life and health, such as food, shelter, and clothing. Nonsubtractive well-being includes whatever is necessary to an agent’s maintaining an undiminished capacity for agency, such as not being the victim of theft, broken promises, malicious slander, or generally unsafe conditions of life and work. Additive well-being, finally, includes whatever is necessary to expand an agent’s capacity for agency, such as having self-esteem and the virtues of prudence, temperance, and courage, as well as education, income, and wealth.
Since all agents necessarily want to be successful in their actions, and since freedom and well-being are necessary to all successful action, all rational agents must find it unacceptable to be deprived of or prevented from having freedom and well-being. Consequently, “[s]ince the agent regards as necessary goods the freedom and well-being that constitute the generic features of his successful action, he logically must also hold that he has rights to these generic features” (Gewirth 1978, 63). For an agent not to claim such rights would be for her to hold that it is acceptable that she is left without freedom and well-being. But she cannot hold this to be acceptable, since she, simply by being an agent, must view freedom and well-being as indispensable goods. Hence, any agent who were to deny that she has rights to freedom and well-being would thereby also involve herself in a contradiction, since she would both hold and at the same time deny that she must have freedom and well-being.
Now, so far, the agent has not made a moral rights-claim. She has only made a prudential rights-claim, that is, a rights-claim that is intended to protect the agent’s own interest in being a successful and efficient agent. However, since the sufficient ground for her rights-claim is simply the fact that she is an agent with purposes that she wants to fulfil, she must also recognize that the same rights-claim can and must be made by all other agents as well. Thus, every rational agent must accept the normative conclusion “All agents have rights to freedom and well-being.” Now this is a moral rights-claim, since it refers to the important interests not only of the individual agent, but of all agents. More precisely, it refers to all prospective purposive agents, since the claim applies not only to persons who are presently involved in agency, but also to persons who in the future can be expected to engage in agency.
Here it is once again important to note that Gewirth does not derive moral rights from facts about agency. His argument is not of the form “Because A is an agent, A has moral rights to freedom and well-being.” Instead he argues that each and every rational agent, from within her own perspective as such an agent, must claim rights to freedom and well-being. That is, from within her own perspective as an agent, A holds that (1) “My freedom and well-being are necessary goods.” Having accepted (1), A, who wants to achieve her goals of action and who is unable to achieve these goals without freedom and well-being, must, on pain of self-contradiction, embrace the evaluative judgement (2) “I must have freedom and well-being.” The “must” of (2) has implications for how A has to conceive of possible threats to her possession of freedom and well-being emanating from other persons. That is, she is logically compelled to hold that (3) “Other persons should not interfere with my having freedom and well-being.” And since (3) is equivalent to claiming a protected possession of freedom and well-being, it is also equivalent to a rights-claim: (4) “I have rights to freedom and well-being.” And since the sufficient condition of A’s rights-claim is that A is an agent, A must then also accept the generalized claim (5) “All agents have rights to freedom and well-being.” While (4) is a prudential rights-claim, (5) is a moral rights-claim, referring to rights had by all agents and not only by A.
Strictly speaking what Gewirth has proven is not that all agents have rights to freedom and well-being, but that all rational agents must hold that all agents have rights to freedom and well-being. However, this does not in any way diminish the practical relevance of Gewirth’s argument. As he himself observes, “what a rational agent ought to do … is what he is rationally justified in thinking he ought to do. But what he is rationally justified in thinking he ought to do is what he logically must accept that he ought to do” (Gewirth 1978, 153). Hence, if every agent must logically accept that all agents have rights to freedom and well-being, then every agent has as good reason as there could ever be to adhere to a moral principle prescribing universal respect for the equal rights of all agents to freedom and well-being.
Such a moral principle is also the outcome of Gewirth’s argument. This is the Principle of Generic Consistency (PGC): “Act in accord with the generic rights of your recipients as well as of yourself” (Gewirth 1978, 135). The term “recipients” refers to the people who are affected by an agent’s action, while “generic rights” denotes rights to freedom and well-being, the generic and necessary goods of agency. Therefore, without any loss of meaning, the PGC could also be stated as “Act in accord with the rights to freedom and well-being of your recipients as well as of yourself.”
The rights prescribed by the PGC are both negative and positive. Agents are required both not to interfere with their recipients’ possession of freedom and well-being, and to help them have freedom and well-being when they are unable to secure these necessary goods by their own efforts, and when help can be given at no comparable cost to the helping agent. To refuse to give such help would be tantamount to a practical denial of the equality of rights prescribed by the PGC.
b. Conflicting Rights
The rights of different agents and recipients may conflict with each other: an unlimited right to freedom for murderers and robbers would allow them to infringe the rights to well-being for their victims; to uphold the right to basic well-being for poor people might require a welfare state that taxes wealthier people and so interferes with their right to property; the additive right to well-being includes a right to have an income, but to have an income from selling drugs to children conflicts with the children’s rights to freedom and basic well-being, and so on. Now, according to Gewirth, conflicts between rights are to be resolved in accordance with three different criteria.
The first criterion is about Prevention or Removal of Inconsistency, according to which agents violating the generic rights of their recipients – aggressor agents, for short – can have their own generic rights justifiably interfered with. Agents who interfere with their recipients’ rights to freedom and well-being by, for instance, coercing them, threatening them, manipulating them, killing them, terrorizing them, assaulting them, or stealing from them are guilty of an inconsistency in that they deny rights to others that they must claim for themselves. Even if they do not make an explicit claim to be superior to other agents, their actions involve a practical rejection of the PGC.
In order to protect or restore the equality of rights prescribed by the PGC, aggressor agents must be either prevented from violating their recipients’ rights in the first place or, if they have already violated these rights, punished for their transgressions. The force used in preventing aggressor agents from violating their recipients’ rights should not exceed what is necessary to protect these rights. Likewise, the severity of the punishment meted out to aggressor agents should be proportionate to the seriousness of the violation of rights that they have inflicted on their victims. Preventing and punishing violations of rights will necessarily involve an interference with aggressor agents’ rights to freedom and well-being, but as it is needed to uphold the equality of rights prescribed by the PGC, such interference is also morally justified by that principle.
The criterion concerning Prevention or Removal of Inconsistency also points to the need for a legal system that can administrate punishment in a fair manner. Such a legal system involve laws, courts, judges, prosecutors, defence lawyers, and police officers. By extension, the justification of such a legal system implies the justification of states that are capable of implementing and upholding rights-protecting laws within their borders.
The second criterion is about Degrees of Needfulness for Action, giving priority to the right whose object is most needed for successful agency. For instance, the right to life (basic well-being) is more important to successful agency than the right not to have one’s property interfered with (non-subtractive well-being). Hence, if I can save a drowning child only at the cost of ruining my clothes, I have a duty to do so. Likewise, at the political or societal level, taxing wealthy people for the sake of providing poor people with basic healthcare or providing their children with basic education is morally justified. It is not that wealthy people do not have a right to non-interference with their property, but instead that this right is overridden by the rights of poorer people to life, health, and education. This is so, not because the poor usually outnumber the rich, but because the specific rights of the poor that we are considering here are more important from the point of view of successful agency than the right of wealthier people to have their wealth left untouched.
While the criterion concerning Prevention or Removal of Inconsistency mainly deals with negative rights – rights not to have one’s freedom or well-being interfered with – the criterion concerning Degrees of Needfulness for Action has more to do with positive rights – rights to have one’s freedom and well-being effectively upheld and protected by other agents. The criterion of Degrees of Needfulness for Action also has a bearing on the justification of what is commonly known as the welfare state, that is, a state which upholds the basic and additive rights of well-being of all citizens by means of redistributive taxation.
The third criterion is about Institutional Requirements, allowing for interference with people’s freedom and well-being when doing so is necessary to uphold institutions and social rules that are themselves required by the PGC. Thus, when a judge sentences a murderer to lifetime imprisonment, she interferes with the murderer’s right to freedom, but she is not thereby doing anything morally wrong. On the contrary, she is representing a legal system upholding the generic rights to freedom and well-being as prescribed by the PGC. More specifically, she represents an institution – the state with its laws, courts, judges, police officers, and so on – designed to remove inconsistencies as described by the first criterion above. The judge is not acting as a private person, but as a representative of the law; therefore, although the convicted murderer has not interfered with the judge’s freedom, he cannot argue against the judge that she has violated the PGC by denying him his right to freedom. This is not a case of an individual agent acting on an individual recipient, but of a representative of the law upholding a moral (and legal) principle of justice.
Many rights are not absolute, as they can be overridden by other, more important, rights, as outlined by the criterion of Degrees of Needfulness for Action. Gewirth hence defends a consequentialist position, according to which the rightness of an action depends on how it affects the recipient’s rights, and, in cases of conflicts between rights, on how upholding one right affects other, and possibly more important, rights. This is what he calls a deontological consequentialism (Gewirth 1978, 216), focusing on protecting rights rather than on producing good results in general. Thus, it should be distinguished from a utilitarian consequentialism, according to which the right action or rule of action is the one that results in the greatest total quantity of happiness or preference satisfaction, regardless of how benefits and burdens, pleasures and pains are distributed among individuals.
According to Gewirth, there are indeed rights that are absolute, in the sense that they cannot be overridden. As an example, he presents the case of Abrams, a young lawyer and prominent member of the society, who is being blackmailed by a group of terrorists threatening to use nuclear weapons against the city in which Abrams lives, unless Abrams publicly tortures his mother to death. So – should Abrams give in to the terrorists’ threats and torture his mother to death for the sake of saving the lives of thousands of his fellow citizens?
Gewirth says no. He provides an argument based on agent responsibility that is capable of explaining why the right to basic well-being of Abrams’s mother in this case is indeed absolute. Central to his argument is the Principle of the Intervening Action. According to this principle, if there is a causal connection between one person A’s action or inaction X and some harm Z being inflicted on some other person C, then A’s moral responsibility for Z is removed if, between X and Z, there intervenes some person B’s action Y, and Y is what actually brings about Z (Gewirth 1982: 229).
In the case of Abrams and the terrorists, the Principle of the Intervening Action means that although there is a causal connection between Abrams’s refusing to torture his mother to death and the deaths of thousands of innocent people, Abrams is not morally responsible for their deaths. This is so because there is an action that intervenes between his refusal and the death of these people and which actually brings about their deaths, namely, the terrorists’ use of their nuclear weapons. It is not Abrams’s refusal by itself that kills thousands of innocent people, but the terrorists’ use of their weapons. No one is forcing the terrorists to kill anyone, least of all Abrams; they freely choose to detonate their bombs or whatever type of weapon they have at their disposal as a response to Abrams’s refusal to torture his mother to death. This is their decision and their action, no one else’s.
Thus, the terrorists are both causally and morally responsible for the deaths of these thousands of innocent people, not Abrams:
The important point is not that he lets these persons die rather than kills them, or that he does not harm them but only fails to help them, or that he intends their deaths only obliquely but not directly. The point is rather that it is only through the intervening lethal actions of the terrorists that his refusal eventuates in the many deaths. (Gewirth 1982: 230)
The conflict here is not between Abrams’s refusal to torture his mother to death and the survival of thousands of innocent townspeople, but between their survival and the terrorists’ intention to use nuclear weapons against them. Consequently, Abrams’s duty to respect his mother’s right to basic well-being is not affected by the terrorists’ threat. In this sense, Abrams’s mother has an absolute right not to be tortured to death by her son. By implication, all innocent persons (and not only mothers) have an absolute right not to be tortured to death by anyone (and not only by their sons).
4. The Community of Rights
The PGC applies not only to individual agents and their interaction with their recipients, but also to the collective level of political communities, institutions, and states. The minimal state with its laws against criminal transgressions such as murder, rape, robbery, fraud, enslavement, and so on is justified as instrumentally necessary to the protection of negative rights to freedom and well-being, that is, rights that are about not having one’s freedom and well-being interfered with. The right to freedom also justifies the democratic state, that is, a state that functions according to the method of consent, allowing the people to be a community of citizens, deciding about their own collective fate, and not just the subjects of an autocratic ruler. But the PGC also justifies a supportive state – in common parlance known as the welfare state – which is instrumentally necessary to the protection of positive rights to freedom and well-being, that is, rights that are about actually possessing the freedom and well-being needed for successful agency. Such positive rights imply that people who are unable to develop, or are prevented from developing, freedom and well-being for themselves should receive support from the state to overcome these obstacles to their successful agency. The support provided would involve access to education, health care, and employment whereby individuals can secure an income for themselves, but also involve public goods such as clean air and water, safe roads, public libraries, and similar commodities that contribute to everyone’s actual possession of freedom and well-being. A supportive state that responds in this manner to its citizen’s positive rights is thereby also a community of rights. The Community of Rights is also the title of Gewirth’s 1996 sequel to Reason and Morality.
According to Gewirth, making the state a community of rights is not only justified in the sense of being permissible but is indeed necessitated by the PGC, as this principle justifies positive rights to freedom and well-being. To act in accord with one’s recipient’s rights to freedom and well-being is not only about not interfering with these goods, but also, when it is necessary, and when one can do so at no comparable cost to oneself, assisting one’s recipients in actually having freedom and well-being. To refuse to help a person who is unable to maintain her basic well-being when one can do so without jeopardizing any aspect of one’s own basic well-being would imply a practical denial of that person’s generic rights of agency. Now, sharing a political community – a sovereign territorial state governed by its citizens – transforms the relationship between agents and their recipients from one of individual persons directly interacting with each other to one of a collective of persons indirectly interacting with each other, by means of social rules and institutions that they or their elected political representatives have decided about. A community of rights aims to remove structural threats to the equality of rights, focusing on “situations where threats to freedom and well-being arise from social or institutional contexts, such as where economic or political conditions make for unemployment, homelessness, or persecution” (Gewirth 1996, 41).
In a political community characterized by social inequality, some people may enjoy prosperous lives with good salaries, wealth, and property, while vast numbers might be left in unemployment and poverty. These poor people may live in unhealthy homes in crime-ridden neighbourhoods, often lacking sufficient education and suffering from a hopelessness that inclines them to abuse drugs and alcohol and to neglect their responsibilities as spouses and parents. Often such inequality has an institutional dimension in that it is being maintained by laws or the absence of laws concerning social welfare, work hours, taxation, property, unionization, and so on. Therefore, providing impoverished and marginalized groups with effective rights to freedom and well-being involves creating a supportive legal and institutional framework that gives them access to education and employment. These goods allow them to make a living for themselves and develop their capacities for successful agency. This is what the community of rights is about.
In this context, it is the state that is the relevant agent of change, rather than individual charity workers, as it is a matter of changing a social condition affecting the political community at large, and as the required changes involve political decisions about laws and institutions. Moreover, as the state derives its moral justification from being instrumental to the upholding and maintenance of its citizens’ equal rights to freedom and well-being, it cannot without undermining its own moral foundation remain passive when confronted with the unfulfilled rights of vast numbers of its citizens.
Acting on behalf of all its citizens, the state can be seen as establishing a link between wealthy and poor groups of citizens, connecting the rights of the poor to the duties of the wealthy: “In so acting the state carries out the mutuality of human rights. For since each person has rights to freedom and well-being against all other persons who in turn have these rights against him or her, the state, as the persons’ representative, sees to it that these mutual rights are fulfilled. … So the state, in helping unemployed persons to obtain employment, enables its other members to fulfill positive duties that, in principle, are incumbent on all persons who can provide the needed help” (Gewirth 1996, 219).
However, here it is important to note that the poor have a right to be helped only when they are indeed unable to secure their rights to freedom and well-being for themselves. The positive right to help is based on necessity – that is, it applies only to cases in which one cannot have one’s rights to freedom and well-being realized without the help of other people or social institutions. Thus, “the positive rights require personal responsibility on the part of would-be recipients of help: the responsibility to provide for themselves if at all possible, prior to seeking the help of others” (Gewirth 1996, 42). Moreover, where there is a justified right to assistance, it is about securing goods needed for successful agency – food, housing, education, a job with a sufficient income, and so on; it is not about satisfying whatever particular need a person might have in the light of her personal interests and preferences.
Central among the positive rights outlined and discussed in The Community of Rights is the one to productive agency. According to Gewirth, unemployment, the lack of education, the lack of affordable health care, and so on, are morally problematic because they deprive persons of their capacity for successful agency. Hence, according to Gewirth, the way to deal with these societal shortcomings is not just to give poor people money but rather to help them develop for themselves the means of self-support, making them capable of standing on their own two feet rather than being reduced to permanent recipients of welfare cheques or charity. To be such a permanent recipient of welfare cheques would be detrimental both to one’s autonomy (central to freedom) and to one’s self-esteem (central to additive well-being); living on welfare is not the solution to the moral problem of poverty but rather a problem in its own right.
Instead of welfare cheques, the community of rights focuses on two mutually reinforcing strategies. At the level of individuals, it aims to develop their capacity for productive work by means of education. At the societal level, it aims to establish a system of full employment combined with a system of economic democracy to be applied to firms competing on market conditions. Gewirth’s ideas here are quite bold, combining ideas usually associated with socialism with a defence of market principles usually associated with liberalism. This comes out clearly in his discussion of economic democracy “in which products are put out to be sold in competitive markets and the workers themselves control the productive organization and process,” which in turn may involve “aspects of ownership either by the workers themselves or by the state” (Gewirth 1996, 260).
Gewirth’s argument that the state is morally obligated to guarantee employment to all citizens reflects his belief that there is a human right to employment. This specific right is derived from the more general right to well-being, as work in exchange for money is a morally justified way of satisfying both basic and additive well-being, enabling oneself to have not only food on the table and a roof over one’s head, but also to buy various consumer goods whereby one can increase one’s quality of life. (Theft, robbery, selling drugs, blackmail, and fraud would exemplify morally unjustified ways of making a living that negatively interferes with others’ well-being.) By participating in the production of goods and services one recognizes the mutuality of human rights by offering goods and services to consumers that they value as components of their well-being, while they in turn pay for these goods and services, thereby contributing to one’s own well-being. By participating in such a mutual exchange, one can also derive a sense of justified self-respect and pride. One contributes something of value to others and earns a living from that contribution. Hence, one is a productive member of one’s community – a person who adds to its total wealth and to the well-being of its members.
The right to productive agency includes a right to education that prepares the individual for work life but also promotes “cultural, intellectual, aesthetic, and other values that contribute to additive well-being, including an effective sense of personal responsibility” (Gewirth 1996, 149–150). In this way, the individual is helped to avoid welfare dependence while at the same time being made aware of human rights and the cultural values of her own as well as other communities. Once again, it is the state, as the institutional representative of the community of rights, that should see to it that all members of the community receive this kind of education.
The right to productive agency implies a right to employment. It has both a negative version – the right not to be arbitrarily deprived of employment – and a positive version – the right to actually have an employment in the first place. The state, representing a community of rights, “should seek to secure the negative right to employment by enforcing on private corporate employers the duty not to infringe this right through policies that disregard their severe impact on the employment security of workers.” As for the positive right to employment, it is also the state “that has the correlative duty to take the steps required to provide work for unemployed persons who are able and willing to work” (Gewirth 1996, 218–219). This latter duty can be effectuated by offering unemployed workers retraining to equip them for a new job, or by the state directly employing them in the public sector.
In addition to defending state interventionism in the job market, Gewirth offers an even more radical solution to the problem of how to protect workers’ rights, namely, economic democracy. Given both the background of universal rights to freedom and well-being and that workers are exposed to the power of their capitalist employers regarding decisions about wages, job security, and conditions of work, Gewirth argues that workers should own and control the companies and corporations that employ them. Still, the Gewirthian idea of economic democracy does not try to dispose of the market, nor does it try to eliminate capitalists as such. What it does is to separate the role of capitalists from the power of ownership. Firms owned and controlled by workers will still compete with each other on a market that is guided by the demands of consumers. These firms will also need capital for investment and development. Sometimes they might need to borrow money from banks or private investors. However, the banks or investors will not themselves be owners or share-holders of the firms in question: “In capitalist systems, capital hires workers; in economic democracy, workers hire capital” (Gewirth 1996, 261).
Firms owned by their workers and competing on a market may of course fail in this competition. In a capitalist system, this would entail that workers lose their jobs as their firm is trying to cover its losses. In a system of economic democracy, however, there will be a general organization of firms that intervenes to prevent such threats to workers’ well-being: “When firms are threatened with failure and consequent layoffs of workers, they are not simply permitted to fail. Instead, the general organization … helps them either to improve their efficiency or to convert to some other line of production in which they can successfully compete” (Gewirth 1996, 295).
Here it is also important to point out that Gewirthian economic democracy does not imply a justification of state socialism of the kind associated with the former Eastern Bloc. On the contrary, Gewirth holds that the introduction of a system of economic democracy must depend on such a system being freely accepted by the citizens in a political democracy. It “should not be imposed by fiat; it should be the result of a democratic process of discussion, deliberation, and negotiation in which arguments pro and con are carefully considered by the electorate of political democracy” (Gewirth 1996, 263). Although Gewirth favours a system of economic democracy, he is also aware of the complexity of the question. The argument for workers’ ownership of firms involves empirical assumptions about motivation, solidarity, and productivity that are not settled by the rational justification of the rights of all agents to freedom and well-being. While political democracy, based on the human right to freedom, and its method of consent are rationally justified and morally necessary, the question of how to best organize the economic structure of the community of rights admits of more than one answer. As Gewirth himself recognizes, “[w]hile there are rational arguments for the economic rights I have upheld, there may also be rational arguments for different and even opposed arrangements, so that the rights have a certain element of normative contingency, as against the generic rights [to freedom and well-being] themselves” (Gewirth 1996, 323).
5. The Good Life of Agents
In his last published book, Self-Fulfillment (1998), Gewirth demonstrated that the necessary goods of agency are central not only to interpersonal and political morality but also to personal morality and the quest for a fulfilling and meaningful life. Distinguishing between two varieties of self-fulfilment, aspiration-fulfilment and capacity-fulfilment, he outlines a normative theory of the good life that is also consistent with the prescriptions of the PGC. In aspiration-fulfilment, the aim is to satisfy one’s deepest desires; in capacity-fulfilment, it is to make the best of oneself. Although these two aims are not mutually exclusive – our deepest desire might be to make the best of ourselves – they are conceptually distinct. For instance, it might be the case that our deepest desires are for other things than making the best of ourselves.
Together, aspiration-fulfilment and capacity-fulfilment define us as persons and agents. In aspiration-fulfilment, we are guided by our actual deepest desires; in capacity-fulfilment, we are guided by an idea of what is best in us that might well go beyond our actual desires and even conflict with them. Here, we should also observe that many people do not have self-fulfilment (in either variety) as the direct and conscious goal of their actions. Instead, “their self-fulfilment and their awareness of it emerge as ‘by-products’ of their achieving the direct external objects of their aspirations, whether these consist in composing beautiful music or pursuing political objectives or whatever” (Gewirth 1998, 50).
Aspiration-fulfilment makes an important contribution to the good life as it provides the aspiring person with motivation and purposes to guide her; thus, “[t]he person who has aspirations has something to live for that is especially significant for him, something that gives meaning, zest, and focus to his life” (Gewirth 1998, 32). However, aspiration-fulfilment can also be problematic, from a prudential as well as from a moral point of view.
Prudentially speaking, one can be mistaken about the contents of one’s deepest desires. Hence, one might aim for targets that will leave one frustrated, either because one fails to understand what it takes to realize them, or because one has an exaggerated view of the satisfaction one will get from realizing them. For instance, one might aspire to become a famous novelist without realizing the effort required to achieve this goal, or one might have exaggerated expectations about the happiness one will get from actually becoming a famous novelist.
From a moral point of view, aspirations can be immoral, conflicting with the human rights to freedom and well-being prescribed by the PGC. One’s deepest desires might be about dominating other people, thereby violating their right to freedom. Or it might be about creating a racially, religiously, culturally or ideologically “pure” society in which people identified as having the “wrong” ethnicity, faith, sexual preferences, or political beliefs are killed, enslaved, imprisoned, or persecuted, thereby having their most basic rights to freedom and well-being violated.
In order to overcome the potential errors of aspirations and reconcile self-fulfilment with the requirements of morality and the PGC, Gewirth moves from aspiration-fulfilment to capacity-fulfilment. This form of self-fulfilment is, as we have already noted, about making the best of oneself. Making the best of oneself involves a move in the direction of objectivity and rationality and away from the subjectivity and arbitrariness of the desires of aspiration-fulfilment. This does not mean that capacity-fulfilment rejects desires. On the contrary: as in the case of aspiration-fulfilment, capacity-fulfilment involves agency, and as there can be no agency without desires for some outcome, “there is ultimately no disconnection between capacity-fulfillment and aspiration-fulfillment” (Gewirth 1998, 159). However, in capacity-fulfilment one’s desires have passed through a process of critical assessment, guided by the goal of making the best of oneself. We might describe this process as the move from aspiration-fulfilment’s question “What do I want for myself?” to capacity-fulfilment’s question “What should I want for myself?”
Now, according to Gewirth, “making the best of oneself” is about acting in accordance with the best of one’s capacities. Reason, as the capacity for ascertaining and preserving truth, would belong to this category of capacities, as it is needed for all rational deliberation, including deliberation about what to do with one’s life, what one should aspire to, how one might best realize one’s aspirations, how to handle conflicts between one’s own goals, or between one’s own and other people’s goals, and so on. In Gewirth’s terminology, reason should be understood as “the canons of deductive and inductive logic, including in the former the operations of conceptual analysis and in the latter the deliverances of sense perception” (Gewirth 1998, 72). In relation to self-fulfilment, we use reason to collect, analyse, and evaluate facts about ourselves and our capacities, as well as to make relevant inferences from these facts and apply them to our aspirations and goals.
One important aspect of ourselves that is ascertained by reason is that we are agents – indeed, the very idea of self-fulfilment implies agency, that is, that we can and should do something with our lives, whether it is about satisfying our deepest desires or making the best of ourselves. Now, as Gewirth has shown in his earlier work, being agents, we must claim rights to freedom and well-being, and we must recognize the claim of all other agents that they too have rights to freedom and well-being. Hence, as capacity-fulfilment involves the use of reason, and as reason justifies human rights to freedom and well-being as prescribed by the PGC, capacity-fulfilment involves recognizing a universalist morality of human rights. Accordingly, to make the best of oneself involves acting in accord with the rights to freedom and well-being of one’s recipients as well as of oneself.
Here we can see how capacity-fulfilment comes to modify aspiration-fulfilment – aspirations that are inconsistent with the human rights to freedom and well-being will be rejected by a rational agent as unjustified and impermissible. Therefore, “capacity-fulfillment can sit in reasoned judgment over aspiration-fulfillment” (Gewirth 1998, 101). Moreover, as agents guided by reason must conceive of freedom and well-being as necessary goods, these goods should also figure prominently in projects whereby agents try to realize a good life for themselves. According to Gewirth, “to fulfill oneself by way of capacity-fulfillment, one must make the most effective use one can of one’s freedom and well-being, within the limits set by the overriding authority of universalist morality” (Gewirth 1998, 110).
“Most effective” should not be understood in purely quantitative terms as the realization of as many goals of action as possible. Instead it is about using one’s critical and reflective understanding of one’s abilities and preferences to select some major goals, such as pursuing a certain career that one finds meaningful, or supporting a cause that one finds valuable. Different agents will make different choices here, depending on their varying abilities and preferences. Some agents may dedicate themselves to human rights activism or to the creation of art that widens the horizons of its audience. However, capacity-fulfilment can also be achieved within more ordinary types of occupations. Thus, people can make the best of themselves by becoming “a professional athlete or an electrician or an engineer or a philosopher or a journalist, and so forth” (Gewirth 1998, 131). Within these various occupations, professions, and callings there will be standards of excellence, and by trying to achieve in accordance with these standards the agent will be able to make the best of herself and so achieve capacity-fulfilment. (Here we should once again remind ourselves that the occupations and professions themselves must be consistent with the human rights to freedom and well-being; hence, an agent would not be able to achieve capacity-fulfilment by excelling as a SS officer in the service of Adolf Hitler or as a NKVD agent working for Joseph Stalin.)
It is important in this context to note that making the best of oneself might well imply different commitments and projects at different times in one’s life. Choosing a particular career for oneself might be an important aspect of one’s capacity-fulfilment when one is young; as one grows older, and all or most of one’s working life belongs to the past, it might be more relevant to have a plan about how to make the most of one’s retirement, possibly developing new skills in the process. Such a dynamic conception of capacity-fulfilment implies a realistic view of human life, according to which “one must accept oneself for what one is; in this way one can age gracefully, as against a neurotic longing for one’s past youth” (Gewirth 1998, 118).
An agent’s effectiveness involves her acquiring certain virtues that enhance her capacity for successful agency. Important among these virtues is prudence, which is the ability to “ascertain which of one’s possible ends are most worth pursuing in light of one’s overall capacities and aspirations,” including “both self-knowledge and knowledge of one’s natural and social environment, as well as the proximate ability and tendency to bring these to bear on one’s actions and projects” (Gewirth 1998, 126).
The development of knowledge about oneself and one’s environment can be promoted by education (including self-education) and culture in the form of art and literature that enlighten and enlarge the agent’s understanding of herself and of the world. As a result of such a widening of her horizons, the agent might find inspiration and motivation to develop her own skills in a way that works well for her, given her talents and abilities.
As the agent tries to achieve her ends, she might be confronted with obstacles in the form of fears, self-doubt, setbacks, frustrations, temptations, and disruptive urges. Thus, she will also need the virtues of courage and temperance, helping her to persevere in the face of adversity and to overcome unfounded fears as well as to control her appetites and inclinations so that they do not undermine her determination and ability to achieve her ends.
A good life for an agent often includes various social commitments. She might experience fulfilment in love relationships or family life, or by participating in various voluntary associations, or by patriotic dedication to her country and political community. By identifying with smaller or larger groups, she might provide her own life with meaning and significance, making the best of herself by being a loyal and supportive member of one or many of these groups. Moreover, “a sense of belonging, of being part of a larger nurturing whole, is a valuable component of additive well-being and self-fulfillment” (Gewirth 1998, 151) as it provides the individual with the identity and confidence needed to make the best of herself.
Social commitments typically involve preferential treatment of other members of one’s group. Lovers typically care for each other in a way that they do not care for others, parents typically support their own children in a way that go beyond whatever support they offer children in general, citizens are typically willing to make sacrifices for their political community that they would not contemplate in relation to other nations or states, and so on. Such particularist allegiances are consistent with the requirements of reason and the principle of equal human rights justified by these requirements – that is, the PGC – as long as the preferential treatment involved does not result in a violation of innocent persons’ rights to freedom and well-being.
Indeed, certain preferential concerns are justified by the PGC. For instance, the right to freedom involves a more specific right to join others in voluntary associations, such as families. In these associations one typically also acquires special responsibilities for each other’s well-being. Parents, for instance, are morally obligated to care for their children as the very existence of these children depend on the parents’ exercise of their freedom to procreate. Likewise, the right to well-being justifies the existence of states as necessary to the protection of that right and makes support for such rights-protecting states a duty for their respective citizens. Therefore, citizens are not only justified but morally obligated to support their state – provided, that is, that the state in question is indeed protective of their human rights and does not unjustifiably threaten the rights of members of other political communities. Such support is effectuated by the citizens when they pay their taxes to maintain rights-protecting institutions or when they take part in the defence of their political community in a just war of defence.
Preferential treatment conflicts with reason and the principle of equal human rights to freedom and well-being only when it involves violations of these rights. A mother does not offend against the universality of human rights by choosing to prioritize the feeding of her own starving child in a situation in which there are many other starving children around. However, things would be different if she feeds her child with food that she has taken from someone else’s starving child; then she would have violated the right to basic well-being of that child. Likewise, a citizen of a rights-respecting state does not offend against the universality of human rights by taking a particular interest in the flourishing of her own political community and by being willing to make sacrifices for that community that she would not make for any other political community. However, she would be guilty of contributing to violations of human rights if her patriotic loyalty were to extend to a support for her political community even as that community violates human rights, for instance, by perpetrating a genocidal attack on a religious or ethnic minority.
Gewirth’s justification of agency-based rights and of the PGC has received many critical comments from other philosophers. Among other things, it has been argued (in the 1984 anthology Gewirth’s Ethical Rationalism, edited by Edward J. Regis Jr.) that agents are not logically compelled to claim moral rights just because they want to be successful in achieving their own goals of action (R. M. Hare); that Gewirth might not have been successful in bridging the gap between the “is” of human agency and the “ought” of morality (W. D. Hudson); that while Gewirth might be capable of justifying negative rights, his theory is unable to justify positive rights and hence also unable to justify the supportive or welfare state (Jan Narveson). Gewirth has replied to these and many other objections (in the anthology mentioned above, as well as in many separate articles in various philosophy journals).
In addition to Gewirth’s own replies to his critics, his theory has been carefully and thoroughly defended by Deryck Beyleveld, who in his 1991 book The Dialectical Necessity of Morality listed 66 categories of objections to the justification of the PGC (often including more than one critic in each category) and went on to show how each and every objection either had already been convincingly dealt with by Gewirth himself or could be dealt with by means of a rational reconstruction of Gewirth’s argument.
In 1997 a conference dedicated to the exploration of Gewirth’s moral philosophy took place at Marymount University, Arlington, Virginia. The comments, presented by the participants in this conference together with a reply by Gewirth himself, were later published as a book with the title Gewirth, edited by Michael Boylan. Gewirth’s theory has continued to attract attention after his death in 2004, including a 2016 anthology entitled Gewirthian Perspectives on Human Rights (edited by the Swedish philosopher Per Bauhn); likewise, the PGC is frequently referred to in discussions relating to human rights and social justice.
One reason for the continued interest in Gewirth’s theory is, of course, that we live in troubled times. As Gewirth himself once pointed out, “[i]n a century when the evils that man can do to man have reached unparalleled extremes of barbarism and tragedy, the philosophical concern with rational justification in ethics is more than a quest for certainty” (Gewirth 1978, ix). Referring to the twentieth century with its two World Wars and the Holocaust, these words have certainly not lost their relevance in the twenty-first century, when mankind is tormented by fanaticism and terrorism, as well as by widespread global inequalities between men and women, and between those who have and those who have not.
The need for a rationally justified morality is as great as ever before in human history, if not greater, given the facts of globalization. Different cultures and moralities are brought in ever closer contact with each other, thereby creating possibilities for conflict as well as for cooperation, while new technologies enable us to affect the lives of people across the globe. Thus, questions of agency, morality, and rights will be of the utmost importance for our deliberations about how to shape our individual and collective futures. It is in the context of such deliberations that Alan Gewirth’s carefully developed arguments have their place; his contributions to modern moral and political philosophy are of a significant and lasting kind.
6. References and Further Reading
a. Primary Works
i. Monographs
- Marsilius of Padua and Medieval Political Philosophy (New York: Columbia University Press, 1951). Gewirth’s doctoral dissertation on the 14th century philosopher who challenged the papal authority in political matters and defended the idea of popular sovereignty.
- Reason and Morality (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1978). Gewirth’s main work in moral philosophy, providing a detailed argument for the Principle of Generic Consistency (PGC) and its derivation from agents’ necessary evaluation of freedom and well-being as the necessary goods of successful agency.
- Human Rights (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1982). A collection of essays by Gewirth, dealing with the justification and application of the PGC.
- The Community of Rights (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1996). Gewirth’s main work in social and political philosophy, in which he provides an argument for positive rights to freedom and well-being, including rights to employment and to economic democracy, as well as for a welfare state that is also a community, based on values such as respect and care.
- Self-Fulfillment (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1998). In this work, Gewirth sets out to argue that self-fulfilment comes in two forms, as aspiration-fulfilment and as capacity-fulfilment, and that making the best of one’s life must include adherence to universal human rights, as defined by the PGC.
ii. Articles and Book Chapters
- “Introduction”, in Gewirth, Alan (ed.) Political Philosophy (London: Collier-Macmillan, 1965), pp. 1–30. This introductory chapter provides valuable clues to Gewirth’s later thinking on political rights and social justice, as well as his early ideas on combining natural law with consequentialism.
- “The Epistemology of Human Rights”, Social Philosophy & Policy 1 (2), 1984, 1–24. In this article Gewirth outlines the conceptual and logical structure of human rights in general and his dialectically necessary justification of the PGC in particular.
- “Practical Philosophy, Civil Liberties, and Poverty”, The Monist 67 (4), 1984, 549–568. Here Gewirth outlines his ideas about how philosophy can be practical, exemplifying by discussing how the poor can be provided with effective access to the political process.
- “Private Philanthropy and Positive Rights”, Social Philosophy & Policy 4 (2), 1987, 55–78. In this article, Gewirth argues that while private philanthropy might contribute to important human values, for reasons of justice and fairness, the primary responsibility for upholding citizens’ positive rights to basic well-being should rest with the state.
- “Ethical Universalism and Particularism”, The Journal of Philosophy 85 (6), 1988, 283–302. Here Gewirth argues that certain particularist commitments, for instance to one’s family and country, are not only consistent with but are indeed justified by universalist morality and its supreme principle, the PGC.
- “Is Cultural Pluralism Relevant to Moral Knowledge?” Social Philosophy & Policy 11 (1), 1994, 22–43. In this article Gewirth addresses the topic of multiculturalism, arguing that the norms and values of different cultures must themselves be assessed from the perspective of rational moral knowledge as embodied in the PGC.
- “Duties to Fulfill the Human Rights of the Poor”, in Pogge, Thomas (ed.), Freedom from Poverty as a Human Right (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007), pp. 219–236. This book chapter is based on “Justice: Its Conditions and Contents”, Gewirth’s keynote address at the XXI World Congress of Philosophy in Istanbul, Turkey, delivered on August 17, 2003. Here Gewirth outlines a positive duty of wealthier nations to provide poorer nations with agency-empowering assistance. This argument can be seen as containing ideas for a book that Gewirth was working on at the time, entitled Human Rights and Global Justice; the book was left unfinished at the time of his death.
b. Secondary Works
- Bauhn, Per (ed.). Gewirthian Perspectives on Human Rights (New York: Routledge, 2016). A collection of essays with new interpretations and applications of Gewirth’s theory, with a particular focus on human rights.
- Beyleveld, Deryck. The Dialectical Necessity of Morality (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1991). An extensive and detailed defence of Gewirth’s argument for the PGC, dealing with sixty-six distinct types of objections made by philosophers; foreword by Gewirth.
- Boylan, Michael (ed.). Gewirth (Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield, 1999). A collection of essays commenting on Gewirth’s theory, how it relates to Kantianism, rationalism in ethics, altruism, and community; the book also contains Gewirth’s replies to the comments, as well as a chronological list of all his published writings up to 1998.
- Regis Jr., Edward (ed.). Gewirth’s Ethical Rationalism (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1984). A collection of critical essays dealing with various aspects of Gewirth’s theory, such as the “is–ought” problem, duties relating to positive rights, and marginal agents; Gewirth replies to his critics in the last chapter.
Author Information
Per Bauhn
Email: Per.Bauhn@Lnu.se
Linnaeus University
Sweden