William Hazlitt (1778 – 1830)

William Hazlitt is best known as a brilliant essayist and critic. His essays include criticism of art, poetry, fiction, and drama. He wrote social and political commentary, portraits of major writers and political figures of his age, and a biography of his great hero, Napoleon. He had intended to follow his father into the Unitarian ministry but became instead a painter of portraits before settling into a career as a writer. His earliest writing is philosophical, and his key ideas are incorporated into his later work as a critic and conversational essayist.

Hazlitt was acquainted with many of the leading figures of the period, including Wordsworth and Coleridge, Keats and Shelley, the philosopher William Godwin, and the essayists Leigh Hunt and Charles Lamb. Like other political radicals of the time, he was persecuted by the Tory press, being referred to disparagingly by one periodical as belonging, with Keats and Hunt, to the ‘Cockney School’. His most notorious work, Liber Amoris (1823), gave ammunition to his enemies by candidly recounting the story of his infatuation with Sarah Walker, the daughter of his landlady, for whom he divorced his wife only to be rejected. He died in 1830, at the age of 52.

Hazlitt was educated at New College, Hackney, a Dissenting academy, where he acquired a thorough grounding in philosophy and literature. He left prematurely, but not before he had begun developing the ideas that he later described as his ‘metaphysical discovery’ and that formed the core arguments of his first book, An Essay on the Principles of Human Action (1805). In this he argues against psychological egoism, materialism, associationism, and a Lockean account of personal identity. He argues for the formative power of the mind and the natural disinterestedness of human action regarding future benefits for oneself and others.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Early Philosophical Works
   1. The ‘Metaphysical Discovery’
   2. Hartley and Helvétius
   3. History of Philosophy
   4. Kant and Idealism
3. Political Thought
   1. Early Political Writing
   2. Virtue and Liberty
   3. The People
   4. The Press and Freedom of Speech
4. The Essayist as Philosopher
   1. Late Twentieth and Early Twenty-First Century Studies
   2. Abstraction and the Poetic
   3. Power and the Poetic
   4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading

1. Life

Hazlitt was born on April 10, 1778, in Maidstone, in the English county of Kent. His Irish father, also named William Hazlitt, was a Presbyterian minister, an author of theological and philosophical works, and a friend of leading Dissenting thinkers such as Joseph Priestley and Richard Price. His mother, Grace, was from an English Dissenting family. In 1780 the family moved to Bandon, County Cork, Ireland. Running into political difficulties with the local community, the Rev. Hazlitt moved the family again, this time to the United States, where he founded the first Unitarian church in Boston but failed to become established. The family returned to England in 1787, to the village of Wem, near Shrewsbury, Shropshire.

William started his formal education in the small school run by his father. He also had periods of schooling in Liverpool, from where he wrote home, precociously, about the injustice of the slave trade and of the Test and Corporation Acts. William intended to follow his father into the Presbyterian, specifically Unitarian, ministry. Because Unitarianism is a rational and politically liberal Dissenting tradition, the family welcomed the French Revolution in 1789. In July 1791 the Birmingham home, library, and laboratory of Joseph Priestley were destroyed by a mob. Young William penned a passionate letter in defence of Priestley, which was published in the Shrewsbury Chronicle.

In 1793 Hazlitt left Wem and the oversight of his father to begin his formal training for the ministry at New College, Hackney, just north of London. This was a Dissenting Academy for the education of lay and ministerial students. If its building rivalled Oxford and Cambridge colleges for grandeur, the curriculum exceeded them in its breadth and its pedagogy in its promotion of free enquiry and philosophical debate. Robert Southey wrote that students ‘came away believers in blind necessity and gross materialism – and nothing else’. Internal disputes and financial difficulties, as well as its reputation as a hotbed of sedition, were already starting to destabilise the college. Many of the students were restless, radicalised by works such as Godwin’s Enquiry Concerning Political Justice (1793) or distracted by the theatres and other pleasures afforded by its proximity to London. Hazlitt left prematurely, having lost his sense of a vocation, but the college had given him a solid grounding in philosophy and literature; and he may already have made the ‘metaphysical discovery’ that would form the basis of his first book.

Hazlitt chose to follow his brother John into a career as a portrait painter, and to live and train with him in London. He soon met leading radicals and thinkers, including William Godwin and Joseph Fawcett. 1798 was a landmark year, as he recalls in his 1823 essay ‘My First Acquaintance with Poets’ (CW 12). When Samuel Taylor Coleridge came to Shrewsbury, to consider a vacancy as a Unitarian minister, Hazlitt went to hear him preach, and later at dinner in Wem, the poet ‘dilated in a very edifying manner on Mary Wollstonecraft and [James] Mackintosh’. Coleridge stayed the night; in the morning he received a letter from Thomas Wedgewood offering him £150 a year to relinquish his ministerial intentions and devote himself to poetry and philosophy, which he immediately accepted. Any disappointment Hazlitt felt was assuaged by the poet’s invitation to visit him at Nether Stowey in Somerset. Delighted, the nineteen-year-old William accompanied Coleridge back to Shrewsbury. On this walk, Hazlitt attempted, with difficulty, to outline the argument of his ‘metaphysical discovery’.

His stay later that year with Coleridge at Nether Stowey, and with Wordsworth at nearby Alfoxton, was another formative experience. The diarist Henry Crabb Robinson, who first met Hazlitt at this time, describes him as a shy and somewhat tongue-tied young man, but also as the cleverest person he knew. By now it was becoming clear that the tide was turning against the radicals and reformers. At a lecture, ‘On the Law of Nature and Nations’, Hazlitt heard James Mackintosh renounce his support for the Revolution and radicalism. Thereafter Hazlitt had nothing but contempt for apostasy of this kind.

Hazlitt painted portraits in Manchester, Liverpool, and Bury St Edmunds. A portrait of his father was exhibited at the Royal Academy in 1802. On a visit to Paris, he caught a glimpse of his hero, Napoleon, and spent hours copying works by Titian, Raphael, and Poussin in the Louvre. He told an Englishman who praised his work that rapid sketching was his forte and that, after the first hour or two, he generally made his pictures worse. He later wrote about his career as a painter in essays such as ‘On the Pleasure of Painting’ (CW 18).

When he was twenty-five, Hazlitt visited the Lake District in Northern England, where Coleridge and Wordsworth were living. The poets regarded him as a moody and easily enraged young man but possessed of real genius. However, the stay ended badly. In 1815, Wordsworth gave an account of the episode to Crabb Robinson as an explanation for his coolness towards Hazlitt. According to this (not necessarily reliable) account, Wordsworth had rescued Hazlitt from a ducking following Hazlitt’s assault of a local woman.

An important new friendship dates from October 1804. Charles Lamb was an old schoolmate and friend of Coleridge and was already a published poet and journalist. Hazlitt also saw a good deal of William Godwin. He was still attempting to get his ‘metaphysical discovery’ into decent order, and it is likely that Godwin advised him. He certainly assisted practically by recommending the work to the publisher Joseph Johnson. The book was published in July 1805. Johnson clearly did not anticipate a huge demand for a work of metaphysics from an unknown author: the first (and only edition in Hazlitt’s lifetime) consisted of just 250 copies, and yet when he was denigrated by the editor of the Quarterly Review, William Gifford, as a writer of third-rate books, Hazlitt responded: ‘For myself, there is no work of mine which I would rate so high, except one, which I dare say you never heard of – An Essay on the Principles of Human Action’ (CW 9: 51).

Mary Lamb, Charles Lamb’s sister, was attempting to interest Hazlitt in a relationship with her friend Sarah Stoddart, who lived in a cottage in Winterslow in Wiltshire. Hazlitt was often busy, so meetings were few and far between. He was working on a second publication, Free Thoughts on Public Affairs (1806). In 1807 he completed his abridgement of The Light of Nature Pursued by Abraham Tucker, and he worked on a series of letters, published in William Cobbett’s Political Register and subsequently as a book entitled A Reply to the Essay on Population, by the Rev. T. R. Malthus (CW 1). Then came his The Eloquence of the British Senate, an anthology of political speeches. Occupied with researching and writing, and still painting, he somehow found time to correspond with Miss Stoddart. She was, at 33, three years older than him. After their largely epistolary courtship, they married on May 1, 1808. The financial interference of Sarah’s brother, John Stoddart, a lawyer and future editor of The Times, rankled with Hazlitt. There were tensions from the start. Sarah liked tidiness and busyness, and despite his recent flurry of publications, she suspected Hazlitt was an idler. In fact, he was working on a book Godwin had commissioned: A New and Improved Grammar of the English Tongue (CW 2). Hazlitt and Sarah went to live in Winterslow. A child was born but lived only a few months. In September 1811, their only child to survive, another William, was born.

Hazlitt worked on a completion of the Memoirs of the Late Thomas Holcroft, which was not published until 1816, in part because Godwin, who had been a close friend of the playwright and novelist, objected to the way Hazlitt had made use of Holcroft’s diary. Earlier, a plan to write a History of English Philosophy had failed due to insufficient subscribers. The scheme was reinvented as a lecture series, with lectures planned on Hobbes, Locke, Berkeley, self-love and benevolence, Helvétius, Price and Priestley on free will and necessity, John Horne Tooke on language, and natural religion. The lectures were delivered at the Russell Institute in Bloomsbury from January 14, 1812. The first lecture was considered monotonous, but subsequently the delivery improved, and Crabb Robinson reported that the final lecture was ‘very well delivered and full of shrewd observation’.  But another attempt to publish the series as a book again failed to attract sufficient subscriptions. Having rejected the ministry, and with only mediocre success as a portrait painter and as a philosopher, Hazlitt was ready for his true vocation: as a journalist, critic, and essayist.

In October 1812 Hazlitt was engaged as a Parliamentary reporter by James Perry, the proprietor of the Morning Chronicle. The four guineas a week he was paid enabled him to move his lodgings to a house in Westminster, one recently vacated by James Mill and owned by Jeremy Bentham, who was also a neighbour (although they may never have met). Within a few months, Hazlitt progressed to an appointment as drama critic, with the opportunity also to contribute political pieces. However, his public support for the fallen Napoleon caused him difficulty with editors. More sympathetic were Leigh Hunt and his brother John Hunt of the Examiner, who were steady in their commitment to political reform. Writing now on drama, painting, and poetry, Hazlitt contributed also to The Edinburgh Review, the leading liberal periodical. Napoleon’s return from Elba in March 1815 and his subsequent defeat at Waterloo represented ‘the utter extinction of human liberty from the earth’. A period of depression and heavy drinking followed. Godwin was one of the few friends who shared his anguish.

Hazlitt’s family situation was difficult. He and Sarah quarrelled, and his brother was now alcoholic and in decline. Hazlitt worked relentlessly to cover household expenses. In 1816 the Memoirs of the Late Thomas Holcroft (CW 3) was finally published, and in 1817 came his first essay collections: The Round Table and Characters of Shakespeare’s Plays (both CW 4). The Round Table shows the mastery of form that Hazlitt had already achieved as an essayist, with 41 titles, including ‘On the Love of Life’, ‘On Mr Kean’s Iago’, ‘On Hogarth’s Marriage a-la-Mode’, ‘On Milton’s Lycidas’, ‘On the Tendency of Sects’, ‘On Patriotism’, ‘On The Character of Rousseau’, ‘Why the Arts are Not Progressive’ and, perhaps most famously, ‘On Gusto’. (There were additional essays by Leigh Hunt in the original edition.)

Hazlitt met John Keats for the first time in 1817: Keats admired him and regarded him as a philosophical mentor. He had also met Percy Shelley, probably at Godwin’s. His relationship with the older Romantics was not good. When John Murray published Coleridge’s long- uncompleted poems ‘Christabel’ and ‘Kubla Khan’, Hazlitt’s reviews displayed the full extent of his frustration with his early mentor. He subsequently criticized Coleridge’s Biographia Literaria vigorously. These attacks upset their mutual friend Charles Lamb and Coleridge himself. Henceforth, in Duncan Wu’s words, Coleridge and Wordsworth ‘dedicated themselves to the dismantling of Hazlitt’s reputation, by fair means or foul’ (Wu, 2008: 191). Hazlitt’s attacks on the poets continued with a review of Robert Southey’s youthful dramatic poem Wat Tyler, which had recently been published against Southey’s wishes. Hazlitt compared its radical sentiments with the poet’s more recent ultra-Royalist articles in the Quarterly Review. But the renegade poets were not the only people he criticized: liberals and reformers were not sacrosanct.

In June 1817, Hazlitt became the drama critic of The Times, which sold 7000 copies a day. The work was exhilarating and exhausting as the two main theatres, Drury Lane and Covent Garden, changed their bills daily, and Hazlitt would often compose the review in his head as he hurried through the streets to dictate it to the printer. In 1818 his reviews were collected in A View of the English Stage. In the same year Lectures on the English Poets was published, based on a lecture series he had given at the Surrey Institution (both CW 5). His lectures had been applauded and cheered, despite some provocative political allusions. The reviews of the books were good, except, inevitably, those in the Tory periodicals. Hazlitt regarded William Gifford, the editor of the Quarterly Review, as ‘the Government’s Critic, the invisible link that connects literature with the police’.

In the summer of 1818 Hazlitt retired to Winterslow to stay by himself at an inn. He wanted to be close to his beloved son, but he was estranged from Sarah. He worked on a new series of lectures, on English comic writers from Ben Jonson to Henry Fielding and Laurence Sterne. By the end of that summer, however, he was rocked by a vituperative article in Blackwood’s Edinburgh Magazine entitled ‘Hazlitt Cross-Questioned’. The author, J. G. Lockhart, the co-editor, had heard from Wordsworth about Hazlitt’s Lake District episode of 1803. The periodical also attacked Keats and Leigh Hunt, ridiculing the three of them as the ‘Cockney School’. It was a scurrilous political campaign, aimed at harming him professionally—and it partly succeeded, for Taylor and Hessey, who had published previous lecture series, withdrew an offer of £20 for the copyright of the Comic Writers series. Hazlitt took legal action and eventually settled out of court, winning £100 damages, plus costs.

Hazlitt now had yearly earnings of approximately £400, some of which he may have gifted to his elderly parents (now living, with his sister Peggy, in Devon). He was not inclined to save money. He was often in default of his rent, and Bentham eventually evicted him. Lectures on the English Comic Writers (CW 6) was published in 1819, followed in August by his Political Essays (CW 7), which included the major two-part essay ‘What is the People’. As usual, the reviews were partisan. William Gifford, in the Quarterly Review, returned to the attack, and the Anti-Jacobin Review called for Hazlitt’s arrest. The attacks, as A. C. Grayling notes (2000: 248), were purely personal. The Government’s repressive measures had raised the political temperature and public discontent. In August eleven people were killed and 600 injured when dragoons charged demonstrators at St Peter’s Field in Manchester.

In November 1819, Hazlitt began a series of lectures on Elizabethan dramatists other than Shakespeare. Lectures on the Dramatic Literature of the Age of Elizabeth was published in February 1820 (CW 6). He was at the height of his reputation, widely recognised as a great critic and prose stylist. In April 1820 he embarked on a series of essays that would further enhance his reputation. These were published as Table Talk, in two volumes in 1821 and 1822 (CW 8). Less polemical than the Round Table essays, they are longer and more reflective. One of the best known of the thirty-three essays is ‘The Indian Jugglers’; others include ‘On Genius and Common Sense’, ‘On the Ignorance of the Learned’, ‘Why Distant Objects Please’, and ‘On the Knowledge of Character’. News of his father’s death had reached Hazlitt belatedly at Winterslow and his feelings about his father are movingly expressed in the essay ‘On the Pleasure of Painting’. After a visit to his mother and sister, he returned to lodgings in London, once again in Southampton Buildings. It was about to become the scene of the most painful episode of his life.

Sarah Walker, the landlady’s daughter, was nineteen. A flirtatious relationship became, on Hazlitt’s side, a passionate infatuation. But Hazlitt was not the only lodger with whom Sarah flirted. When he overheard Sarah and her mother talking lewdly about other lodgers, he was shocked and frustrated. He decided to push Sarah towards a commitment by freeing himself to marry. By February 1822 he was in Scotland, where divorce was easier to obtain, arranging for his wife to discover him with a prostitute. A period of residence in Scotland was required, and he spent the time writing, also lecturing on Shakespeare. His wife’s attitude was pragmatic, and she took the opportunity to walk independently in the Highlands.

News from London concerning Sarah Walker’s behaviour caused Hazlitt additional agony; he rushed to see her only to be met with a cold reception. After a tormented week, he returned to Edinburgh to complete divorce proceedings, then back in London, newly single, he witnessed Sarah Walker walking with his main rival, John Tomkins, in a way that convinced him they were lovers. By now he regarded her as ‘a regular lodging-house decoy’. His friends witnessed the ‘insanity’ of his conflict of adoration and jealousy. Meeting him in the street, Mary Shelley was shocked by his changed appearance. As late as September 1823, visiting London from Winterslow, he spent hours watching Sarah Walker’s door. Hazlitt chose now to compile from his notes and letters a confessional account of the whole affair. This became Liber Amoris, or The New Pygmalion (CW 9), his most notorious book. It was published anonymously in 1823, but no one doubted its authorship. It caused an uproar and allowed his enemies further to impugn his morality and his judgment.

During his period of infatuation, both Keats and Shelley had died. Before his death, Shelley had collaborated with Leigh Hunt and Lord Byron to launch a new journal, The Liberal. One of Hazlitt’s contributions was ‘My First Acquaintance with Poets’, the essay in which he discusses his early meetings with Coleridge and Wordsworth, and which ends with an affectionate tribute to Lamb. If Hazlitt’s literary power was undiminished by those recent events, his financial situation certainly was, and in February 1823 he was arrested for debt. It was an unpleasant experience, but brief because his friends were able to supply ‘terms of accommodation’. He now resumed his regular contributions to periodicals, and he started work on the character portraits that would be republished in The Spirit of the Age (CW 11) in 1825. It sold well and is considered one of his finest achievements. The men portrayed include Bentham, Godwin, Coleridge, Sir Walter Scott, Lord Byron, Southey, Wordsworth, Mackintosh, Malthus, Cobbett, and Lamb.

A relief to his emotional struggles and financial crisis presented itself, conveniently, in the form of marriage to an independent woman, Isabella Bridgewater. She was intelligent and educated, a widow with £300 a year. Their love (or understanding) developed rapidly, and in early 1824 they were in Scotland (where his divorce was recognised) to get married. They then embarked on a continental tour, during which he contributed travel pieces to the Morning Chronicle, subsequently published (in 1826) as Notes of a Journey Through France and Italy (CW 10). In Paris they visited the Louvre. His hopes and commitments had not changed since his last visit in 1802. In Florence he visited Leigh Hunt and Walter Savage Landor. He liked Venice more than Rome but admired the Sistine Chapel. They returned via the Italian Lakes and Geneva, where he enjoyed scenes associated with Jean-Jacques Rousseau.

In 1826 Hazlitt finished preparing for publication the essays collected in his final major collection, The Plain Speaker (CW 12). These included some of his greatest essays, such as ‘On the Prose Style of Poets’, ‘On the Conversation of Authors’, ‘On Reason and Imagination’, ‘On Londoners and Country People’, ‘On Egotism’, ‘On the Reading of Old Books’, ‘On Personal Character’, and, perhaps best known, ‘On the Pleasure of Hating’. The book was published in May 1826, in the same month as Notes of a Journey. Settled in Down Street, Piccadilly, with Isabella, without financial worries, Hazlitt contemplated his most ambitious work: a biography of Napoleon. Researching this would require a prolonged stay in Paris. This, or perhaps young William’s unfriendly manner towards his step-mother, unsettled Isabella, and the marriage foundered. It was said that she had fallen in love with Hazlitt because of his writings and parted from him because of the boy.

By December 1827 Hazlitt was complaining of ill-health. In February 1828 he wrote his ‘Farewell to Essay Writing’, a powerful justification of his ‘unbendingness’: ‘What I have once made up my mind to, I abide by to the end of the chapter’ (CW17: 319). He returned to Paris to pour everything into the completion of The Life of Napoleon Buonaparte (CW 13 – 15). Then, back in London, he continued a project he had started in autumn 1827: a series of ‘conversations’ with James Northcote (1746 – 1831), the artist and former pupil and biographer of Sir Joshua Reynolds. Crabb Robinson reported that there was ‘more shrewdness and originality’ in Northcote and Hazlitt himself than in Dr Johnson and James Boswell. The essays Hazlitt wrote in the last few months of his life showed no signs of decline. One, ‘The Sick Room’, describes his pleasure in reading when ‘bed-rid’: ‘If the stage shows us the masks of men and the pageant of the world, books let us into their souls and lay open to us the secrets of our own. They are the first and last, the most home-felt, the most heart-felt of our enjoyments’ (CW 17: 375 – 76).

Having been often disappointed by the course of European history, Hazlitt survived long enough to hear that the Bourbon monarchy had been overthrown. He wrote in his final essay, ‘On Personal Politics’, that should the monarchy be restored once more, liberty would live on because the hatred of oppression is ‘the unquenchable flame, the worm that dies not’ (CW19: 334n). Hazlitt died on 18 September 1830, most likely from stomach cancer. He was 52. According to his son, his last words were, ‘Well, I’ve had a happy life’. He was buried in the churchyard of St Anne’s, Soho. The funeral was arranged by Charles Lamb, who had been with him when he died.

2. Early Philosophical Works

a. The ‘Metaphysical Discovery’

At the age of sixteen or seventeen Hazlitt made a ‘metaphysical discovery’. It would be another ten years before he could articulate this insight to his satisfaction and work out its wider implications. When the work containing them, An Essay on the Principles of Human Action (CW 1), was finally published in 1805, it was largely ignored. From the late twentieth century on, it has received more attention than ever before. Hazlitt did not pursue a career as a metaphysician, but the ideas remained central to his thinking: he found ways better suited to his genius to infiltrate them into public consciousness.

The ‘metaphysical discovery’ occurred as Hazlitt was reading Baron d’Holbach’s arguments for self-love. He contemplated the possibility that we have a greater tendency to altruism than Hobbes, and most philosophers since, had allowed. Voluntary action concerns future consequences, so questions about egoism and altruism are ultimately about the individual’s relation to his future self. Psychological egoism suggests that even an apparently benevolent action has an underlying selfish motivation, and Hazlitt does not deny that this can be the case, but he wonders what accounts for it. Is the principle of self-love inherent in human nature, or is there a metaphysical case for questioning this dispiriting conclusion?

Hazlitt argues as follows. If I now regret an earlier generous action and, looking back, hold my past self accountable, I am presuming a continuity of personal identity between past and present—and with good reason, for my past self is causally connected to my present self through memory. There is some kind of ‘mechanical’ or psycho-physiological process that connects my past decisions to my present consciousness. But if I now anticipate a future benefit or injury to myself, resulting from a present decision, there can be no comparable connection because the future has not occurred, it does not exist. Therefore, Hazlitt insists, a principle of self-interest cannot apply to my future self: at least, not one that posits an actual continuity or identity of self through time. But is there not some faculty of mind that connects me to it, and is this not as ‘personal’ to me, as exclusive, as memory and consciousness are? These faculties give me access to my past and present experience of a kind that I cannot have to anyone else’s: is not my anticipation of my future experience a directly parallel case?

Hazlitt argues that it is not. There is, currently, no future self. The faculty of mind that anticipates the future self is imagination and, yes, it allows me to anticipate my future, but only in the same way as it allows me to anticipate your future or anyone else’s. We are ‘thrown forwards’ into our futures but not in the intimate, exclusive way in which we connect through memory with our past or through consciousness with our present. The connection I have with my future self, through imagination, has the same degree of disinterestedness or impersonality as my relationship with another person’s future self. An action that might be described as motivated by self-love could equally be described as motivated by disinterested benevolence, for my future self has the metaphysical status of otherness.

This seems counterintuitive. It is true that I can anticipate another person’s pleasure or pain to some extent, but not with the same force or degree of interest as I do my own. Hazlitt knows that we do, as a matter of fact, have a bias towards our own future interests, and that this provides some sense of continuity. However, his supposition is that this bias is acquired: the selfishness that other philosophers argued was inherent is actually the result of nurture, of socialisation. The point is not that benevolence is inherent, but that humans are ‘naturally disinterested’, and therefore we could be educated to think and act differently.

For some commentators this reorientation of the argument concerning egoism and altruism is the Essay’s main point of interest, while for others it is the argument for the discontinuity of personal identity. John Locke had argued in An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (first published in 1689) that what makes someone the same person today as yesterday, or as in their distant childhood, is memory. His ‘Prince and Cobbler’ example, in which the memories of each switch bodies, was intended to show that psychological rather than physical continuity is what guarantees identity through time (Locke, 1975: 340). This was questioned by Thomas Reid in his Essays on the Intellectual Powers (1785). His  ‘General and Ensign’ example suggested that personal identity could not be reduced to psychological continuity (Reid, 1983: 216 – 218). Renewed interest in the question from the 1960s onwards produced a range of fission-based thought experiments that led Derek Parfit, for example, to conclude that it is not personal identity that matters but some degree of psychological survival (Parfit, 1987: 245 – 302). In some scenarios it might not be me who persists, but someone qualitatively very much like me.

Hazlitt appears to have anticipated this distinction. He employs a multiple-fission example to show that the kind of connection we have with our future self cannot guarantee personal identity. What if the connection between past and present were non-causal: could that produce identity? If Person A’s consciousness were replicated (non-causally) in Person B, would A not feel ‘imposed upon’ by a false claim to identity? Anticipating twentieth-century examples involving multiple replicants, such as Parfit’s ‘Mars Tele-Transporter’ example, Hazlitt asks: if a Deity multiplied my self any number of times, would they all be equally myself? Where would my self-interest lie? He concludes: ‘Here then I saw an end to my speculations about absolute self-interest and personal identity’ (CW 12: 47). Hazlitt’s point is that if the concept of personal identity cannot be carried through with logical consistency to a future self which is one and the same as the present self who acts, neither can the idea of the necessity of self-interested action. In any case, although what I am now depends on what I have been, the chain of communication cannot run backwards from the future to the present. If the Deity multiplied me any number of times in the future, or destroyed me, it could not affect my present self.

My only interest in a future self comes from the psychological bias I have acquired from experience, including my upbringing, and if I have thereby acquired a sense of self and a capacity for sympathy with my future self, I have equally acquired a potential for sympathy (empathy) with others. My future self is in fact one of those others with whom I can empathize. Imagination enables me to project out of myself into the feelings of others. Moreover, ‘I could not love myself, if I were not capable of loving others’ (CW1: 2). If this implies that I could not wish good things for my future self if I did not wish good things for the future selves of others, it prompts the question: what motivates the desire for good things to happen to anyone?

Hazlitt’s position suggests an account of child development that sees children as learning in stages to distinguish between self and others and to identify with their own current and anticipated longer-term interests. He knew that people sometimes fail to acquire a moral sense and that they can be driven by circumstances to evil, yet still, he argues, they must have in choosing between alternative actions some notion of good. So, although he rejects the hypothesis that we are naturally self-interested, he admits that there is something which is inherent, that ‘naturally excites desire or aversion’, and this is ‘the very idea of good or evil’. Regardless of what I think makes a future consequence a good one, ‘it cannot be indifferent to me whether I believe that any being will be made happy or miserable in consequence of my actions, whether this be myself or another’ (CW 1: 11 – 12).

It follows from this that both selfish and altruistic actions are in a sense impersonal, for it is the idea of good that motivates, rather than a rational calculation or allocation of benefits. Hazlitt may have had in mind a role for parenting and education in refining and extending the child’s understanding of good. The sensitivity of the faculty of imagination in differentiating degrees of good and evil is improvable. No doubt, in anticipating a future benefit or pleasure, imagination can stimulate an illusion of continuous identity, and the satisfaction one gains from imagining one’s own future pleasure is especially forceful because I know from experience what my future feelings might be, but this does not make the connection with the future self parallel with the connection with one’s past self: it is still a fiction. Imagination provides the freedom to think in a more expansive way, to project one’s love of good beyond self-interest to others one is close to, and beyond to others unknown. It is the freedom to aspire to universal benevolence.

Hazlitt’s disjunction between the self, as constituted by memory and consciousness, and the putative future self appears to have been an original observation. We have seen how Hazlitt has been said (for example, by Martin and Barresi, 1995) to anticipate Parfit on personal identity. A. C. Grayling (2000: 363 – 4) finds a parallel between Peter Strawson’s argument concerning other minds and Hazlitt’s ‘transcendental’ argument that being capable of having an interest in other people’s future is a condition for being capable of having an interest in one’s own. Just as, according to Strawson, one can ascribe states of consciousness to oneself only if one can ascribe them to others, which suggests that observable, bodily behaviours constitute logically adequate criteria for ascribing states of consciousness to others, so, according to Hazlitt, one’s relation to one’s future self has the same status as one’s relation to another person’s future self and this suggests that it must be a condition of acting benevolently towards oneself (self-interestedly) that one can act benevolently towards others.

b. Hartley and Helvétius

The Essay has a second part, Remarks on the Systems of Hartley and Helvétius. David Hartley (1705 – 1757) had presented a physiological and mechanical account of the impact of sensation on the brain. Ideas become associated through repetition, so that one sensation can cause, involuntarily, multiple ideas. For Hazlitt this form of associationism provides an insufficient account of the mind. A physiological chain of vibrations, or the ‘proximity of different impressions’, can no more produce consciousness than ‘by placing a number of persons together in a line we should produce in them an immediate consciousness and perfect knowledge of what was passing in each other’s mind’. Furthermore, the suggestion that different ideas have a definite location in the brain is simply absurd; nor can associationism account for the mingling of different experiences in one idea, as when one hears with joy the song of a thrush and imagines it coming beyond the hill from some warm wood shelter. Every beginning of a series of association must derive from some act of the mind which does not depend on association. Association, where it does exist, is only a particular and accidental effect of some more general principle. Hartley’s account leaves no room for such voluntary mental activity as comparison of one idea with another, for abstraction, reasoning, imagination, judgment—in short, ‘nothing that is essential or honourable to the human mind would be left to it’.

Helvétius (1715 – 1771), Hazlitt’s other disputant in the second part of the Essay, had argued (in De l’esprit, 1758) for a materialist theory of mind and for self-interest as the sole motive of human action, a reduction of right and wrong to pleasure and pain: benevolent actions are an attempt to remove the uneasiness which pity creates in our own minds. Therefore, any disinterestedness hypothesis must be wrong, because only self-gratification provides the required causal mechanism. Hazlitt responds, firstly, that this is irrelevant to the issue. The relation of voluntary action to the future does not differ according to whether the principle impelling it is directed towards the self or towards others. It is no more mechanical in the former case than in the latter. Secondly, there is no reason to resolve feelings of compassion or benevolence into a principle of mechanical self-love. We are necessarily affected emotionally by our actions and their consequences: it would be ‘palpable nonsense’ to suggest that to feel for others we must in reality feel nothing. If all love were self-love, what would be the meaning of ‘self’? It must either point to a distinction in certain cases or be redundant. There must be clear limits to the meaning of the term ‘self-love’; but, in any case, purely as a matter of fact, Hazlitt thinks, it is incorrect to think that we have a mechanical disposition to seek our own good, or to think that, when we act benevolently, an accompanying pleasure sensation necessarily displaces the painful feeling occasioned by another’s distress.

The relevant distress is the other person’s, not my own; it is the relief of his or her distress that I will. To the argument that my love of others amounts to self-love because ‘the impression exciting my sympathy must exist in my mind and so be part of me’, Hazlitt responds that ‘this is using words without affixing any distinct meaning to them’. After all, any object of thought could be described as a part of ourselves: ‘the whole world is contained within us’. If any thought or feeling about or for another person is directed not to them but to me, then by the same token I might sometimes be said to be filled with self-hate: ‘For what is this man whom I think I see before me but an object existing in my mind, and therefore a part of myself?… If I am always necessarily the object of my own thoughts and actions, I must hate, love, serve, or stab myself as it happens’ (CW 1: 89 – 90).

Hazlitt concludes the Essay by affirming the common-sense view that compassion for another person’s injury is not a selfish feeling. When I am wounded, the pain is the effect of ‘physical sensibility’; when I see another person’s wound, my experience of pain is ‘an affair of imagination’. Benevolence ‘has the same necessary foundation in the human mind as the love of ourselves’ (CW 1: 91).

c. History of Philosophy

Hazlitt’s intention to write a history of English philosophy was first heard of in 1809 when an eight-page pamphlet was published advertising ‘Proposals for Publishing, in One Large Quarto… A History of English Philosophy: containing an Account of the Rise and Progress of modern Metaphysics, an Analysis of the Systems of the most celebrated Writers who have treated on the Subject, and an Examination of the principal Arguments by which they are supported. By the Author of An Essay on the Principles of Human Action, and An Abridgement of the Light of Nature Pursued’ (CW 2: 112). By 1810 Hazlitt had decided to turn the History into a series of essays, and in January 1812 these became lectures. After the lecture series had been successfully completed, the Proposals for a History of English Philosophy was republished, with a list of subscribers, but assured sales were too few to cover production costs and the book was never published. Most of the lectures were eventually published as essays in Literary Remains of the Late William Hazlitt in 1836.

The Proposals (entitled Prospectus in Howe’s Complete Works) outlines the positive claims on which Hazlitt’s critique of English philosophy would be based. These include the following: that the mind is not material; that the intellectual powers of the mind are distinct from sensation; that the power of abstraction is a necessary consequence of the limitation of the comprehending power of the mind; that reason is a source of knowledge distinct from, and above, experience; that the principle of association does not account for all our ideas, feelings and actions; that there is a principle of natural benevolence in the human mind; that the love of pleasure or happiness is not the only principle of action, but that there are others implied in the nature of man as an active and intelligent being; that moral obligation is not the strongest motive which could justify any action whatever; that the mind is not mechanical, but a rational and voluntary agent—it is free in as far as it is not the slave of external impressions, physical impulses, or blind senseless motives; and that the idea of power is inseparable from activity—we get it from the exertion of it in ourselves (CW 2: 116 – 119).

The lectures of 1812 included ‘On the Writings of Hobbes’, ‘On Locke’s Essay’, ‘On Self-Love’, and ‘On Liberty and Necessity’. In the first of these he argues that, contrary to popular opinion, Locke was not the founder of ‘the modern system of philosophy’. He sees Locke as a follower of Hobbes. Hazlitt’s argument in these essays takes forward the aim referred to in his Proposals, to oppose ‘the material, or modern, philosophy, as it has been called’, according to which ‘the mind is nothing, and external impressions everything. All thought is to be resolved into sensation, all morality into the love of pleasure, and all action into mechanical impulse’ (CW 2: 113 – 4). This theory, he writes, derives from a false interpretation of Francis Bacon’s use of the word ‘experience’, according to which the term applies to external things only and not to the mind. To apply the experimental methodology of natural philosophy to the mind is to assume an affinity based on ‘no better foundation than an unmeaning and palpable play of words’ (CW 2: 114).

In ‘On Liberty and Necessity’, Hazlitt largely agrees with Hobbes’s account of necessity as implying no more than a connection between cause and effect. Free will is not unmotivated: the motives which cause free actions originate in the mind. ‘The will may be said to be free when it has the power to obey the dictates of the understanding’ (CW 2: 255). Liberty is not an absence of obstruction or an uncertainty, it is ‘the concurrence of certain powers of an agent in the production of that event’. It is as real a thing ‘as the necessity to which it is thus opposed’ (CW 2: 258 – 9).

In the same year as the Proposals first appeared (1809), Hazlitt published A New and Improved Grammar of the English Tongue (CW 2). Hazlitt claims some originality for his theoretical and logical analysis of language. He rejects the assumption that grammatical distinctions and words of different kinds relate to different sorts of things or ideas rather than to our manner of relating to them. The same word can play many roles: what changes is the way things are reordered in relation to one another in our thoughts and discourse. A substantive, for example, is not the name of a substance or quality subsisting by itself but of something considered as subsisting by itself. It is an abstraction. Grammatical distinctions also mark changes in the orientation of the speaker to the hearer (‘the poisonous plant’ vs. ‘the plant is poisonous’). Verbs, like adjectives, express attributes and direct the hearer either to a familiar connection between things or to a new or unknown one. Verbs are not the only words that express ideas of being, doing, or suffering, but they have a certain eminence in that, without them, we cannot affirm or deny, ask for information or communicate a desire, express or understand an idea. Hazlitt appears to have grasped something of the pragmatics, in addition to the syntactical and semantic features, of language and communication.

Hazlitt acknowledged the importance and influence of John Horne Tooke’s The Diversions of Purley (1786), which had provided a general theory of language and the mind, but he disagreed with Tooke’s ideas concerning abstractions. He returned to this in ‘On Abstract Ideas’ and ‘On Tooke’s Diversions of Purley’, two of the lectures delivered in 1812. Tooke agrees with Hobbes, Hume, Berkeley, and others that there are no abstract or complex ideas. Hazlitt counters that, on the contrary, ‘we have no others’, for if all ideas were simple and individual we could not have an idea even of such things as a chair, a blade of grass, a grain of sand, each of which is a ‘certain configuration’ or assemblage of different things or qualities. Every idea of a simple object is ‘an imperfect and general notion of an aggregate’ (CW 2: 191). ‘Without the cementing power of the mind, all our ideas would be necessarily decomposed… We could indeed never carry on a chain of reasoning on any subject, for the very links of which this chain must consist, would be ground to powder’ (CW 2: 280).

Hazlitt alludes to an idea that was to stay central to his philosophical outlook: ‘The mind alone is formative, to borrow the expression of a celebrated German writer’ (CW 2: 280). How much did Hazlitt know of Immanuel Kant’s philosophy and to what extent was he an idealist? One reason for asking this is that the debate concerning politics and epistemology, brought to the fore by the empiricism of Burke’s Reflections on the Revolution in France (1790), enticed Romantic writers to explore, as Timothy Michael puts it, ‘the idea… that it is through rational activity that things like liberty and justice cease to be merely ideas’ (Michael, 2016: 1). Hazlitt was one writer who went some way towards idealism. It promised a potential alternative to Godwin’s utopianism, to Bentham’s felicific calculus, and to Burke’s arguments from experience and tradition.

d. Kant and Idealism

 Hazlitt’s opinion that particulars are abstract ideas constructed by an abstract entity we call ‘the mind’ suggests that he had absorbed at least some of the ideas of idealism. He is opposed to any materialist epistemology that has no place for the active power of the mind, but he does not agree with Berkeley that there is no mind-independent world. We can, to an extent, experience an external reality but we cannot conceptualize, know, or understand it without the mind’s faculty of abstraction.

‘Abstraction,’ Hazlitt writes, ‘is a trick to supply the defect of comprehension’. This sentence occurs in the Preface to his 1807 abridgement of Abraham Tucker’s The Light of Nature Pursued. He goes on to argue that abstraction is only half of the understanding: common sense is also needed, and he sees Tucker’s ‘sound, practical, comprehensive good sense’ as the great merit of his (too-voluminous) work (CW 1: 125). There are only two sorts of philosophy: one ‘rests chiefly on the general notions and conscious perceptions of mankind, and endeavours to discover what the mind is, by looking into the mind itself; the other denies the existence of everything in the mind, of which it cannot find some rubbishly archetype, and visible image in its crucibles and furnaces, or in the distinct forms of verbal analysis’. The latter can be left to chemists and logicians, the former is ‘the only philosophy fit for men of sense’.

Hazlitt himself connects Tucker’s philosophy with Kant’s. Tucker ‘believed with professor Kant in the unity of consciousness, or “that the mind alone is formative,” that fundamental article of the transcendental creed’. It is not clear when Hazlitt first became acquainted with Kant’s philosophy. Before he had finished preparing the arguments of the Essay for publication, in 1805, he may have encountered Friedrich August Nitsch’s A General and Introductory View of Professor Kant’s Principles concerning Man, the World and the Deity, submitted to the Consideration of the Learned (1796) or John Richardson’s Principles of Critical Philosophy, selected from the works of Emmanuel Kant and expounded by J. S. Beck (1797) or the same writer’s later publications, but it is most likely that he had encountered Anthony Willich’s Elements of the Critical Philosophy (1798). We know that Coleridge possessed a copy of Willich’s Elements, and he may well have discussed Kant’s philosophy directly with Hazlitt, or with a mutual acquaintance such as Godwin or Crabb Robinson. By 1807, possibly by 1805, Hazlitt certainly knew something of Kant and appreciated him as a formidable opponent of ‘the empirical or mechanical philosophy’ and as a proponent of the doctrine of the creative and active power of the mind.

Hazlitt had definitely seen Willich’s translation by 1814. In his review of Madame de Staël’s Account of German Philosophy and Literature, he mentions Willich’s summary of the Critique of Pure Reason as including the proposition that ‘We are in possession of certain notions a priori which are absolutely independent of all experience, although the elements of experience correspond with them, and which are distinguished by necessity and strict universality’ (CW 20: 18). A footnote takes issue with this idea: ‘This, if the translation is correct… is, as it appears to me, the great stumbling block in Kant’s Philosophy. It is quite enough to shew, not that there are certain notions a priori or independent of sensation, but certain faculties independent of the senses or sensible objects, which are the intellect itself, and necessary, after the objects are given, to form ideas of them’. Having rejected Locke’s doctrine of the mind as a blank slate, Hazlitt was not keen to fill it with what he saw as innate ideas. Whether he or Willich is to blame for the misreading, it seems that, even in 1814, Hazlitt’s understanding of Kant’s philosophy was incomplete.

Did he appreciate Kant’s moral philosophy? There is, perhaps, some similarity between the categorical imperative and the role the mind plays in Hazlitt’s account of disinterested voluntary action. Certainly, for Hazlitt moral action is dissociated from a calculation of material advantage. It is not utilitarian or teleological, but neither is it exactly deontological in the sense of being based on universal rules or duties. There are parallels with Kant’s notion of a priori understanding in that moral action is conformity to a moral standard that is not derived from sensory experience, but for Hazlitt sensory experience is not all experience. Moral action is free of self-interest, but it is not free of selfhood, of the passions and habits and dispositions of the individual self. Hazlitt’s faculty of imagination lacks the purity of Kant’s idea of reason. Its recognition of good is based on experience and past preferences, so the active nature of the individual mind does not entail that reasonable choices converge.

3. Political Thought

a. Early Political Writing

One of the intellectual virtues that Hazlitt championed as a critic and essayist was openness, in the sense both of open-mindedness and of candour. This does not mean that he was flexible in his core political commitments. On the contrary, he valued a principled steadiness. True to his Dissenting roots, he was unshakeable in his commitment to civil and religious liberty and in his opposition to Toryism, the war with France, and the restoration of the Bourbon monarchy. Like many of his generation, he admired Godwin’s Enquiry Concerning Political Justice, but not uncritically, and if he espoused the politics of radical reform, he did so with a degree of skepticism concerning the modifiability of human nature. His open-mindedness and candour meant that he was prepared to criticize, and to antagonize, people who shared his commitments, and to praise those with whom he disagreed politically.

After the Essay was published, Hazlitt was quick to apply its fundamental insights to politics. In his 1806 pamphlet Free Thoughts on Public Affairs (CW 1), he denounces the ‘false patriotism’ of Tory policies, seeing it as a cover for militaristic nationalism, imperialism, and the erosion of constitutional rights. He blames the recently deceased William Pitt the Younger for diffusing ‘a spirit of passive obedience and non-resistance’ (CW 1: 112). He does not reject, as Godwin had done, the legitimacy of the state as an institution, but he insists that a radically reformed state and senate should reject selfish attachments in favour of disinterested policies that bring universal benefit. In this early statement of his political commitments, the ‘metaphysical discovery’ underpins his opposition to tyranny, capitalism, and imperialism.

In The Eloquence of the British Senate (CW 1), an anthology of political speeches (with commentary), published in 1807, Hazlitt makes clear his commitment to the British people’s right and constitutional duty ‘to resist the insidious encroachments of monarchical power’. He condemns the political corruption rampant in the parliamentary system and praises (pre-1789) Edmund Burke and Charles James Fox for their disinterested patriotism and benevolence. In the same year he composed five letters addressed to Thomas Malthus, three of which were published in William Cobbett’s Political Register. Malthus had originally written An Essay on the Principle of Population (1798) in response to Nicolas de Condorcet’s and Godwin’s optimism about the consequences of social improvement. Malthus’s argument that population growth would inevitably outstrip the potential for subsistence was proving influential even in Whig circles. Godwin’s major response would not be published until 1820; meanwhile, Hazlitt’s letters were a significant contribution to the defence of social progress and justice. Hazlitt condemns Malthus’s fatalism and advocacy of the principle of self-love. He also opposed Samuel Whitbread’s Malthusian Poor Bill, which proposed a national system of parochial schools, which, in Hazlitt’s view, would indoctrinate and further increase the vassalage of the poor. Like Godwin, he saw any such state-sponsored system as undermining independence of thought and the principle of popular democracy.

b. Virtue and Liberty

As Hazlitt’s career as a journalist, critic, and essayist developed, he focused on the particular and the individual rather than on abstract principles, but his opposition to the unjust exercise of power was clear and consistent. His Preface to Political Essays (1819) emphasizes his commitment to autonomy, to candour, to opposing selfishness and corruption. He writes:

I am no politician, and still less can I be said to be a party-man: but I have a hatred for tyranny, and a contempt for its tools… I have no mind to have my person made a property of, nor my understanding made a dupe of. I deny that liberty and slavery are convertible terms, that right and wrong, truth and falsehood, plenty and famine, the comforts or wretchedness of a people, are matters of perfect indifference. (CW 7: 7)

Openness, integrity, and sincerity are the virtues Hazlitt opposes to the temptations of advancement through corruption or the allure of power. ‘The admiration of power in others,’ he writes, ‘is as common to man as the love of it in himself: the one makes him a tyrant, the other a slave’ (CW 7: 148). The willingness of a people to become the instruments of tyrants and oppressors allows power to claim legitimacy. It does not speak well for human nature if it can be seduced in this way. Once embedded in people’s minds, power is almost irremovable. This hatred of unjust power explains Hazlitt’s opposition to hereditary monarchy and the idea of divine right; and it explains also, and more controversially, his admiration for Napoleon, whom he came to see as the final bastion against the threat to liberty represented by European monarchies.

Though not a ‘party-man’, Hazlitt thinks like a modern politician when he concedes the need to make pragmatic and partisan concessions in the cause of liberty:

If we were engaged in a friendly contest, where integrity and fair dealing were the order of the day, our means might be as unimpeachable as our ends; but in a struggle with the passions, interests, and prejudices of men, right reason, pure intention, are hardly competent to carry through: we want another stimulus. The vices must be opposed to each other sometimes with advantage and propriety. (CW 17: 40)

Integrity sometimes permits one to speak truth to power in language that power understands.

Freedom of will and political freedom are linked in Hazlitt’s conception of the mind’s innate power, subject only to the laws of its own innate constitution, and arbitrary political power which tries to make us passive machines. Both kinds of power may be tyrannical, and we are too inclined to admire political power in others. Uttara Natarajan observes that in his conversational essays we see Hazlitt attempting to translate into practice the ideal of the innate power of the individual resisting arbitrary political power (1998: 116). Potentially the most powerful instrument in the cause of liberty, poetry is neutral, and the power of language can be put to use on either side. In a sense liberty and political power are unevenly matched, for the former is diffused and the latter concentrated, and liberty must contend also with ego, pride, and prejudice. As with the will of individuals, it is not inevitable that the will of the people will be directed to the common good, but at least it has the capacity to be so directed.

That provides at least a degree of hope; yet Hazlitt sometimes comes close to despair about the prospects for genuine change. In one of his many aphorisms, he states:

If reform were to gain the day, reform would become as vulgar as cant of any other kind. We only shew a spirit of independence and resistance to power, as long as power is against us. As soon as the cause of opposition prevails, its essence and character are gone out of it; and the most flagrant radicalism degenerates into the tamest servility. (CW 20: 333)

Nevertheless, it was important to sustain resistance, to exert freedom of the will, in order to retain whatever liberty remained.

c. The People

Like Winston Smith in George Orwell’s Nineteen Eighty-Four, Hazlitt looks to the proletariat. In essays depicting country people and townspeople, he characterizes both with frankness. A Cockney is someone who ‘sees and hears a vast number of things, and knows nothing’ (CW 12:  66). By his lack of servility, ‘Your true Cockney is your only true leveller’ (CW12: 67). Whereas the county dweller is petty and parochial, the urban dweller benefits from his exposure to the mass of people. London is described as ‘a visible body-politic, a type and image of that great Leviathan’. The urban social experience is an emancipation from ‘petty interests and personal dependence’.

Hazlitt recognises that although differences of character, talent, and discrimination mean there is undeniable superiority in particular spheres of life, including art, poetry, and criticism, nevertheless, superiority ‘arises out of the presupposed ground of equality’ (CW 8: 208). The benefit that ordinary people gain from society, from ‘free communication and comparing of ideas’, is denied to people of rank, ‘where all is submission on one side, and condescension on the other’. He is astonished by the airs and graces some people give themselves when there is so ‘little difference… in mankind (either in body or mind)’. Individual achievement is grounded in the essential equality of the people: ‘I am proud up to the point of equality—every thing above or below that appears to me arrant impertinence or abject meanness’ (CW 20: 123). Differences are largely due to disparities of opportunity and esteem.

In two powerful essays entitled ‘What is the People?’ (CW 7), Hazlitt attacks efforts by Southey and others to associate parliamentary reform with insurrection. The Poet Laureate criticizes the maxim vox populi vox Dei—the voice of the people is the voice of God. Hazlitt’s answer to the question What is the people? is:

Millions of men, like you, with hearts beating in their bosoms, with thoughts stirring in their minds, with blood circulating in their veins, with wants and appetites, and passions and anxious cares, and busy purposes and affections for others and a respect for themselves, and a desire for happiness, and a right to freedom, and a will to be free’. (CW 7: 259)

He launches into a ferocious attack on his antagonist, who would lay the mighty heart of the nation ‘bare and bleeding at the foot of despotism’, who would ‘make the throne every thing, and the people nothing’ and be himself a ‘cringing sycophant, a court favourite, a pander to Legitimacy.

This notion, legitimacy, is nothing other than the old doctrine of Divine Right ‘new-vamped’. The purpose of the Government should be to benefit the governed; its interests should not be at variance with those of the people, which are common and equal rights, yet the Government, Hazlitt thinks, sees its interest as preserving its privileges and those of the great and powerful. The dog kennels of the great and powerful are ‘glutted with the food which would maintain the children of the poor’. The people obstruct their absolute power; therefore rulers will always try to root out ‘the germs of every popular right and liberal principle’. How can rulers such as these be expected to have sympathy with those whose loss of liberty is their gain? The wealth of the few is composed of ‘the tears, the sweat, and blood of millions’ (CW 7: 264 – 5).

If a corrupt, self-interested Government cannot be trusted to serve the people’s interest, what can? There is no better solution, Hazlitt insists, than a popular democracy: ‘Vox populi vox Dei is the rule of all good Government: for in that voice, truly collected and freely expressed… we have all the sincerity and all the wisdom of the community’. In fact, the closer we can get to a direct democracy, in which each individual’s consciousness of his or her own needs and desires is registered, the better. In the opposite extreme (hereditary despotism), the people are ‘an inert, torpid mass, without the power, scarcely with the will, to make its wants or wishes known’ (CW 7: 268).

Hazlitt does not appear to endorse Godwin’s anarchistic localism, for he thinks representation and universal suffrage is the closest to direct democracy that can be achieved, but there are Godwinian themes when he addresses, in the second part of the essay, the question ‘Where are we to find the intellect of the people?’. His answer is everywhere. Public opinion incorporates ‘all those minds that have ever devoted themselves to the love of truth and the good of mankind’ (CW 7: 269). Lord Bacon was a great man, but not because he was a lord; Burke received his pension from the King, but not his understanding or his eloquence. What have hereditary monarchs ever done for the people? What wisdom is there in the Established Church, in the slave trade, in error, inhumanity, corruption and intolerance, in Church-and-King mobs but not in petitions for parliamentary reform? According to Hazlitt,

‘Loyalty, patriotism, and religion, are regarded as the natural virtues and plain unerring instincts of the common people: the mixture of ignorance or prejudice is never objected to in these: it is only their love of liberty or hatred of oppression that are discovered… to be the proofs of a base and vulgar disposition. (CW 7: 271)

Vox populi is the voice of God because it is the cry raised against ‘intolerable oppression and the utmost extremity of human suffering’ (CW 7: 278). Freed from attempts to stifle it or give it a false bias, it must lead ‘to the gradual discovery and diffusion of knowledge in this as in all other departments of human knowledge’. Indoctrinated by the Church and State, the people have been denied a proper (non-catechistic) education, and therefore the opportunity to ‘take the management of our own affairs into our own hands, or to seek our fortunes in the world ourselves’. Liberty requires the people to want it more than they want power, and to recognise their oppression. He shares with Godwin the view that individual judgment will improve when people are allowed to exercise it.

To develop his attack on the hereditary principle, Hazlitt invents a fable or thought experiment. He supposes that the actor Edmund Kean takes out letters patent ‘to empower him and his heirs for ever… by the grace of God and the favour of the Prince Regent’  to take the lead in all future stage tragedies, regardless of actual talent, and despite the fact that his son is ‘a little crook-kneed, raven-voiced, disagreeable, mischievous, stupid urchin, with the faults of his father’s acting, and none of his fine qualities’ (CW 7: 274). Unless forced to attend at the point of a bayonet, the public would simply stay away. ‘Surely, if government were a thing requiring the utmost genius, wisdom, virtue, to carry it on, the office of King would never even have been dreamt of as hereditary, any more than that of poet, painter, or philosopher’ (CW 7: 274). Near idiots are supposed capable of ruling while the people are denigrated as ‘a swinish multitude’ and mocked for their lack of refinement and philosophy. When will the ‘long minority’ of the people expire? Despotic rulers, tenacious of power, should indeed fear the people’s fury, even if timely reform might prevent, or delay, a revolution.

‘What is the People?’ is Hazlitt at his most polemical. The pronouns ‘we’ and ‘our’ become prominent as he aligns himself with the people. His tendency to skepticism about enduring progress is suppressed in favour of a defiant tone that conveys the tensions in the period before the Peterloo Massacre of 1819. It is in stark contrast to the aloof voice of An Essay on the Principles of Human Action, though the militant is identical with the metaphysician.

d. The Press and Freedom of Speech

The idea of a disinterested state of mind, first developed in the Essay, grounds Hazlitt’s political thinking and, specifically, his commitment to freedom of speech and the liberty of the press. The faculties of mind, including imagination, are active and receptive, and they develop through exposure to ideas and beliefs that are encountered through conversation and, especially, through reading. We are naturally disposed to sympathize with the feelings of others, but our faculties need cultivation. We need to be challenged and to exercise judgment in the careful consideration of different points of view, and without prioritising our own interests or settled opinions.

The invention of printed books made knowledge more widely available, and the press is, potentially at least, ‘the great organ of intellectual improvement and civilisation’ (CW 13: 34). Hazlitt was, of course, aware that periodicals could equally be organs of Government propaganda. Editors, booksellers, and publishers were prosecuted under the Sedition and Libel acts more often than authors themselves. For example, in 1798 Joseph Johnson, the publisher of the Essay, and of Hazlitt’s father’s sermons, of Priestley, Wollstonecraft, Godwin and others, was tried and imprisoned for sedition. John Hunt, Hazlitt’s friend and the publisher of The Examiner and The Yellow Dwarf, was twice imprisoned. William Cobbett fled to the United States to avoid arrest. Hazlitt is often at his most splenetic (and least disinterested, perhaps) in considering the editors of the Tory press and their turncoat contributors. In the former category is William Gifford, the editor of the Quarterly Review. Hazlitt describes him as being so well qualified for the situation ‘by a happy combination of defects, natural and acquired’ that at his death ‘it will be difficult to provide him a suitable successor’ (CW 11: 114).  Mercilessly denouncing Whigs and Radicals as ‘dunces and miscreants’, Gifford ‘entitles himself to the protection of the Church and State’ (CW 11: 117). People like this ‘poison the sources of public opinion’ (CW 11: 124). A puppet press manipulates public opinion, diverting it from truth, justice, and liberty. Without the opportunity to develop independent thinking, individuals cannot break free from prejudice and received opinion.

The discontinuity of personal identity is alluded to, ironically, in Hazlitt’s response to Southey’s attempt to suppress the unauthorised publication, in 1817, of his youthful dramatic poem Wat Tyler, which the Poet Laureate now regarded as seditious. The former Radical had become a strong opponent of parliamentary reform and of free speech. What could prompt such a turnaround? Hazlitt imputes it ‘rather to a defect of moral principle than to an accession of intellectual strength’ (CW 7: 180). Hazlitt had admired the Lake poets’ earlier work, but he insists on his right to criticize them in print. Integrity requires Hazlitt to speak truth, also, to those allies he feels sometimes undermine the cause: Godwin was too utopian, Percy Shelley too extreme, Robert Owen disingenuous in claiming originality. The underlying idea is still disinterestedness: a critical, candid, disinterested response to the spirit of the age, to the cacophony of its leading voices. What would be the point of independent, disinterested judgment if, from tact or pusillanimity, one preferred self-censorship to candid free speech? Freedom is the right to criticize and disagree.

4. The Essayist as Philosopher

a. Late Twentieth and Early Twenty-First Century Studies

Interest in Hazlitt, and especially in his philosophy, was largely dormant throughout Victorian times and most of the twentieth century. Herschel Baker (1962) and W. P.  Albrecht (1965) both comment on the philosophy, in Baker’s case none too favourably, but it is since Roy Park’s 1971 study that interest has been sustained. Several biographies and critical studies have appeared that have attempted to do justice to Hazlitt the philosopher and political thinker, as well as to Hazlitt the critic and conversational essayist. These include biographies by A. C. Grayling (2000) and Duncan Wu (2008). Stanley Jones (1989) focuses on Hazlitt’s later life. David Bromwich’s intellectual biography The Mind of the Critic (1983) is recognised as a major critical study of Hazlitt as a leading figure of Romanticism. John Kinnaird (1978) traces Hazlitt’s use of the term ‘power’ in both political and creative contexts. Tom Paulin (1998) emphasizes Hazlitt’s genius as a prose stylist and radical thinker. Stephen Burley (2014) places Hazlitt’s life and thought in the context of his Unitarian upbringing and education and focusses on his early philosophical work. Kevin Gilmartin (2015) puts politics at the centre of Hazlitt’s achievement as a critic and essayist. A major collection of essays by several authors, Metaphysical Hazlitt: Bicentenary Essays (2005) marked the bicentenary of Hazlitt’s Essay on the Principles of Human Action and explored its relevance to his other work.

These works testify to the modern interest in Hazlitt’s overall achievement. But it is worth taking a closer look at two distinctive interpretations of the philosophy, focused on different key concepts, in order to relate them to his work as a critic and essayist. Park’s Hazlitt and the Spirit of the Age (1971) focuses on what he sees as Hazlitt’s entirely original theory of abstract ideas; Uttara Natarajan’s Hazlitt and the Reach of Sense: Criticism, Morals, and the Metaphysics of Power (1998) focuses on Hazlitt’s insistence on the formative power of the mind. Both books investigate how Hazlitt’s philosophical commitments were integral to the style and content of the literary essays on which his reputation as a writer rests.

b. Abstraction and the Poetic

Roy Park argues that Hazlitt’s theory of abstraction explains the role that both painting and philosophy played in the formulation of his literary theory. He emphasizes how Hazlitt disguises the philosophy in his essays by focusing the reader’s attention on the concrete and particular. He sees partial parallels with the thought of Coleridge, Thomas Carlyle, and Mathew Arnold in the way Hazlitt represents abstraction as a threat to our experience of the poetic—which is to say, to civilized living. Literature is a response to life at its deepest level, to life experienced imaginatively rather than rationally. Contemporary philosophers, such as Bentham, Condorcet, even Godwin, represent humankind in materialistic terms. ‘Experience’ should not be restricted to material or physiological experience. The moral theories of egotism and utilitarianism, which make pleasure and pain the only criteria of right action, also Malthus’s theory of population, are the outcome of empirical epistemology. Park sees Hazlitt as attempting (like Thomas Reid) to harmonize the ‘material’ with the ‘intellectual’ or ‘imaginative’, and (like Francis Bacon) the abstract with the concrete, the individual with the universal, the scientific with the spiritual (1971: 20 – 21).

Hazlitt was not interested, Park writes, in converting the poetic into something other than itself. To ask What is the poetic? is an improper question, for the essence of poetry and life are lost when we attempt to explain them. It is not so much that thought is mysterious as that mystery is part of the thought. Hazlitt’s experiential response to the poetic and the existential was appreciated by Percy Shelley and John Keats: ‘Hazlitt initiated the response… but it is to Keats that we owe the classic formulation of the experiential standpoint in his characterization of negative capability as a condition in which “man is capable of being in uncertainties”’ (Park, 1971: 32).

Park sees Hazlitt’s objection to abstraction as being an objection ‘to all closed systems of thought in which the whole of human experience was interpreted in the light of the system’s initial premiss, empirical or metaphysical, with scant regard to the individuality, complexity and diversity of “the truth of things”’ (1971: 35). He quotes Hazlitt’s observation in the Lectures on English Philosophy:

‘They [system-makers] have in fact always a purpose… [which] takes away the tremulous sensibility to every slight and wandering impression which is necessary to complete the fine balance of the mind, and enable[s] us to follow all the infinite fluctuations of thought through their nicest distinctions. (CW 2: 269; Park, 1971: 37)

One of Hazlitt’s objections to Wordsworth’s ‘The Excursion’ is that it has ‘palpable designs upon us’.

Hazlitt’s Essay prepared the way for his rejection of abstraction by its rejection of mechanical associationism and of psychological egoism, and by its discovery of natural disinterestedness and the active power of the mind. Park thinks Hazlitt’s analysis of personal identity is not as significant as the argument against psychological egoism or the positioning of the imagination—the faculty of self-transcendence—as the moral faculty. It is the prerequisite for the openness characteristic of the existential stance. Furthermore, Park argues, it parallels Kant’s autonomously legislative will: practical reason and imagination are both essentially experiential.

But imagination’s role is not just as a mode of volitional consciousness: it is also the faculty of the poetic (1971: 49). Hazlitt connects imagination with the vital role played by sentiments in developing our habits and affections. The existential or sentimental relationship with the world around us is what Hazlitt calls ‘the poetry of life’—what makes life worth living. Imagination extends beyond volitional consciousness to include art and life in general. We are poetical animals because we love, hope, fear, hate, despair, wonder, admire. For Hazlitt, the spirit of poetry and the spirit of humanity are the same. The past becomes a fable, investing objects with value; objects become epiphanies. Childhood is important for its ‘symbolic fecundity and its subsequent symbolic richness’ (Park, 1971: 66). Poetry expresses this revelation of the significance of human life, modifying and enlivening the mystery of existence, the real and interior spirit of things. Value is quality, not, as in Bentham’s utilitarianism, quantity. The fine arts and poetry are self-authenticating; their value is never instrumental: ‘they toil not, neither do they spin’ (CW 18: 167). But that is not to say that they have no cultural implications for the individual or for society. Through literature and the arts, we are humanized: they enable us to become aware of our inter-relatedness with the rest of humanity.

Intellectual progress is not towards abstraction, as Locke and later philosophers had thought, but towards individuation. Objects of sense are complex; they are ‘seen’ with our understanding and our hearts: the more we observe, the more we see. Hazlitt, Park observes, had learned this as a painter. Detail is the essence of the poetic. Hazlitt’s critical vocabulary is full of terms derived from painting, terms related to the kind of ‘gusto’ appropriate to that branch of literature, and terms connected with particularity and individuation: ‘detail’, ‘distinction’, ‘tint’, ‘local’, ‘concrete’, ‘subtle’, and the contrasting terms such as ‘abstract’, ‘vague’, ‘universal’, ‘indefinite’, ‘theoretical’. It is out of particularity that the universal emerges. It is the precise and the vague that are in opposition, not the individual and the general. Park observes that Hazlitt’s attitude to abstraction helps us to understand his own view of his work as ‘the thoughts of a metaphysician expressed by a painter’.

Hazlitt’s use of this term ‘gusto’ epitomises his experiential view of the poetic. Derived from art criticism, it refers to the particular character of a work of art or literature: the quality which, as it were, differentiates one grain of sand from another. What the work expresses, in all its complexity, can only be expressed in the work itself. Our job is to submit to the artist’s or poet’s vision. In an essay that itself exemplifies gusto, ‘The Indian Juggler’, Hazlitt refers to the poet’s ability to unravel ‘the mysterious web of thought and feeling’ through ‘the power of that trembling sensitivity which is awake to every change and every modification of its every-varying impressions’ (CW 8: 83).

Philosophers are too connected to their form of abstraction. Park quotes Ludwig Wittgenstein (1958: 18) on the ‘craving for generality’ and the tendency of philosophers to try to answer questions in the way that scientists do (Park, 1971: 210). Feeling is the most important factor in Hazlitt’s distrust of abstraction. Imagination is the power of carrying feeling into other situations, including into other people’s situations. Park uses the term ‘imaginative sincerity of feeling’ to refer to the power of imagination at work in art and in moral action. This and gusto and the distrust of abstraction are all facets, Park insists, of Hazlitt’s experiential view of the poetic: they give a unity to his criticism (1971: 169). The combination and balance between these facets serve to isolate the peculiar, original, and characteristic nature of a work in relation to the artist’s individual genius, and to discriminate kinds and degrees of poetic excellence.

Park argues that for Hazlitt hope lies in the nature of poetry itself and in the spirit of man. His disappointment with his own age is demonstrated in The Spirit of the Age (CW 11), published in 1825, a work Park describes as ‘a masterpiece of indirectness’, an ‘aggregate of well-founded particulars’ (1971: 213 – 214). It is like an historical painting of the age, starting with portraits of Bentham, Godwin, and Coleridge, and proceeding with writers and politicians that exemplify aspects of the times or who, like Coleridge, had capitulated to the spirit of the age. Abstraction is to blame for its political and aesthetic limitations: the principle of utility, for example, is characteristic.

c. Power and the Poetic

Uttara Natarajan thinks the attention given by Park to Hazlitt’s criticism of abstraction is ‘at the expense of the larger theoretical framework of his writing’ (Natarajan,1998: 6). She calls for the recognition of Hazlitt as not only a great critic but also as a profound philosopher. Hazlitt’s criticism of art and literature, and his political and social criticism, is pervaded by the epistemology and metaphysics of the Essay, and also by its moral theory. Her main claim is that all Hazlitt’s subsequent thought follows from what she sees as the central idea of the Essay: the concept of power. Power is the independence of the mind from manipulation by the senses (or, equivalently, by external objects). The concept of power ‘is at the very core of Hazlitt’s celebration of all intellectual activity as the vindication of an innate self-directing principle with which the mind is endowed (Natarajan,1998: 27).

The formative power of the mind is evidenced by the structure of language, and poetic language especially has a reach that extends beyond the mind to objective reality. In Natarajan’s view, therefore, Hazlitt’s linguistic philosophy is more important than has previously been recognised. Language is the means by which we can understand the self. Words affirm, Natarajan writes, ‘the relation between mind and nature: the moral goal, unity’ (1998: 146). Unity is always a function of the self-projecting attribute of the mind and its ability to create relations and perceive wholes. Language is not a limitation but a manifestation of the mind’s power.

Whereas ordinary language does not reveal externally ‘subsisting objects’, poetic or ‘inspired’ language is true to nature when it conveys the impression the object makes on the mind. Its role is to evoke things as they are felt by the speaker, their emotional significance. Hazlitt’s term ‘impression’, Natarajan observes, is imbued with the weight of feeling. The prime mover is not the object itself but the imagination: it is constructive, it assembles the whole. The power of human perception is embodied in the ‘excess of the imagination beyond the actual or ordinary impression of any object or feeling’ (1998: 27). Hazlitt ‘grants to the purely intellectual a degree of actuality equal to, if not greater than, the impressions of the sense’ (1998: 39). It is through the apprehension of imagination that, in Wordsworth’s words, we ‘see into the life of things’.

Natarajan reminds us that Hazlitt had been educated in Unitarianism, in which God is the power that unifies the order of creation. In Hazlitt’s work, the human intellectual faculty replaces the divine. ‘Nature’ and ‘truth’ are imagination embodied in words. Imagination brings about a process of association, whereby it projects itself into the order of nature to produce its own immaterial creation, its own unity. This active form of associationism opposes the mechanical, materialist, passive, and deterministic associationism of Hartley and Priestley. We never see the whole of an object by looking at it: we ‘read’ it with an associative power that allows it endlessly to accrue meaning. The mind is no blank slate; rather, nature is the blank that gains meaning from the mind. It grows with its growth. Looking into nature is looking into oneself, and vice-versa.

Hazlitt adopts a pluralistic view of truth: it ‘is not one but many; and an observation may be true in itself that contradicts another equally true, according to the point of view from which we contemplate the subject’ (CW 9: 228). Truth is an aggregation, a universal composed of particulars, a union of the abstract and the concrete, synthesized by the imagination. A point of view is true when it is authentic and produced, as in poetry and art, from well-founded particulars. Poetic truth is individualistic, an original insight made possible by the poet’s experience and circumstance and influenced by innate biases or predispositions. This suggests a paradox of determinism simultaneous with free volition. The agent’s dispositions influence choices, but the idea of freedom of the will refers to the choice between motives, which is an inner activity, not externally directed. So, although an agent, artist, or poet is inevitably constrained by the constitution of his or her own mind, it is precisely this that creates the individuality to which she or he must be true. Imaginative truth is an exclusive original insight: truth but not the truth. The artistic genius is compelled to communicate this truth to us, almost tyrannically, in a kind of ‘transfusion of mind’, and yet this is also a sublimation of self.

Hazlitt’s idea of the empowered mind, Natrajan observes, is where his linguistics, epistemology, and poetics converge. It provides, too, a model of the self ‘at once the origin and the product of power’ (Natarajan, 1998: 78). Self-love and benevolence are identically manifestations of innate imagination. By refuting the mechanistic and passive notion of the self, Hazlitt is able to emphasize the capacity of the mind to apprehend holistically both self and others. ‘Alterity’, Natarajan writes, ‘validates the moral nature of man… If that which is other to the self can be shown to constitute a real motive to action, then the self owns moral agency (1998: 121). However, there is a love of power in the mind independent of the love of good. Hazlitt emphasizes this especially in The Plain Speaker essays (CW 12), where empowered mind is shown as bigoted and exclusive. To reach a just determination, we must set aside the bias of the will, the mind’s dispositions. This reconciliation of wisdom and power is achievable because the self is the instrument for action, not the motive. Whereas ‘power’ expresses moral capacity, ‘good’ expresses moral purpose. The ‘metaphysical discovery’ shows the mind’s imaginative capacity, not its achievement, but it allows us to adjust our motives to suit this new understanding of the self as naturally disinterested and to expand the circle of our sympathy.

d. Conclusion

Natarajan and Park agree that a full appreciation of Hazlitt as a philosopher requires us to explore the philosophy in his criticism and conversational essays as well as in his earlier, more explicitly philosophical works. His role in the conversational essays is to be both an artist and a moralist, to create and to criticize, to entertain and to enlighten, and sometimes to enrage. As Natarajan points out, he constantly revisits favourite themes, qualifying, refining, contradicting, aggregating, and composing. Like Michel de Montaigne, whom he admired, Hazlitt was not afraid to turn the spotlight on himself and to explore his own contradictions. Despite its huge variety, there is a unity in his work, a continuity of interests, and commitments that reaches right back into young adulthood. His ideas and themes continue to deserve to be revisited. Interpretation and appreciation of his philosophy has flourished since Park’s and Natarajan’s books were published, and interesting approaches continue to be explored.

Charles Lamb’s review of the first volume of Table Talk provides a fine assessment of his friend’s achievement:

To an extraordinary power of original observation he adds an equal power of familiar and striking expression… In fact, he all along acts as his own interpreter, and is continually translating his thoughts out of their original metaphysical obscurity into the language of the senses and of common observation. (Lamb, 1980: 306 – 7)

5. References and Further Reading

Bibliographical note: references to Hazlitt’s works are generally to the 21-volume Complete Works, edited by P. P. Howe, and are indicated by CW + volume number.

• Hazlitt’s Complete Works:
• Howe, P. P. (ed.) 1930-34. The Complete Works of William Hazlitt. 21 vols. London: Dent.
  • This is the standard edition of Hazlitt’s writing. It contains texts of the full-length volumes, annotated. Not quite complete. It is available from the Internet Archive.
• Selections, Letters and Memoirs:
• Cook, Jon (ed.). 1998. William Hazlitt: Selected Writings. World’s Classics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A one-volume paperback selection with useful annotations and an introduction. It contains some of Hazlitt’s shorter philosophical essays and some of his aphorisms.
• Dart, Gregory (ed.). 2005. William Hazlitt: Metropolitan Writings. Manchester: Carcanet Press.
  • A collection of Hazlitt’s major metropolitan essays, with a critical introduction on his attitude to London life.
• Dart, Gregory (ed.). 2008. Liber Amoris and Related Writings. Manchester: Carcanet Press.
  • Sets Liber Amoris, Hazlitt’s memoir of the main crisis of his life, in the context of his other writings from 1822-23, with notes and a critical introduction by the editor.
• Hazlitt, William Carew. (ed.) 1867. Memoirs of William Hazlitt. 2 volumes. London: Richard Bentley.
  • Edited by Hazlitt’s grandson. Includes portions of his correspondence. Available from Internet Archive and Forgotten Books.
• Keynes, Geoffrey (ed.). 1948. Selected Essays of William Hazlitt. London: Nonesuch Press.
• Mee, Jon and Grande, James (eds.). 2021. The Spirit of Controversy and Other Essays. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A useful, updated World’s Classics edition. The texts are drawn from the original periodical publications, rather than those subsequently prepared for book publication.
• Paulin, Tom and Chandler, David (eds.). 2000. William Hazlitt: The Fight and Other Writings. London: Penguin
  • Substantial annotated Penguin Classics selection, with an introduction by Tom Paulin.
• Sikes, Herschel Moreland, Bonner, William Hallam, and Lahey, Gerald (eds.). 1978. The Letters of William Hazlitt. New York: New York University Press.
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 1998. The Plain Speaker: The Key Essays. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Paperback selection of some of Hazlitt’s best essays, plus a newly discovered essay, ‘A Half-Length’. Introduction by Tom Paulin.
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 1998. The Selected Writings of William Hazlitt. 9 vols. London: Pickering and Chatto.
  • A major selection: nine-volumes, with updates of Howe’s texts and annotations. Introduction by Tom Paulin. It includes two previously unpublished essays and An Essay on the Principles of Human Action but excludes much of the philosophical writing to be found in CW 20).
• Wu, Duncan (ed.). 2007. New Writings of William Hazlitt. 2 vols. Oxford: Oxford University.
  • A collection of 205 more recently discovered writings, including major essays on the poetry of Wordsworth and Coleridge and some late philosophical essays not previously recognised as Hazlitt’s.
• Wu, Duncan. 2014. All That is Worth Remembering: Selected Essays of William Hazlitt. London: Notting Hill Editions.
• Biographies:
• Baker, Herschel 1962. William Hazlitt. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• Grayling, A. C. 2000. The Quarrel of the Age: The Life and Times of William Hazlitt. London: Weidenfeld and Nicholson.
  • A lively biography which appreciates the man and the philosophy.
• Howe, P. P. 1947 (new edition). The Life of William Hazlitt. London: Hamish Hamilton.
  • A standard biography, which draws heavily on Crabb Robinson’s diary. Useful but dated.
• Jones, Stanley. 1989. Hazlitt: A Life. From Winterslow to Frith Street. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • An important critical biography. Covers later part of Hazlitt’s life and work.
• Wu, Duncan. 2008. William Hazlitt: the First Modern Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • An important and substantial biography by a leading Hazlitt scholar.
• Critical and Historical Studies:
• Albrecht, W. P. 1965. Hazlitt and the Creative Imagination. Lawrence, Kan.: University of Kansas Press.
  • A study of Hazlitt’s concept of imagination, his political thought and his literary judgements.
• Barbalet, Jack. 2009. ‘Disinterestedness and Self-Formation: Principles of Action in William Hazlitt’. European Journal of Social Theory, 12 (2), 195 – 211.
• Bromwich, David.1983. Hazlitt: The Mind of a Critic. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major modern study of Hazlitt’s philosophy, politics, criticism, and moral theory. Makes the case for Hazlitt as a major critic.
• Bullitt, J. M. 1945. ‘Hazlitt and the Romantic Conception of the Imagination’. Philological Quarterly, 24.4, 343-61.
• Burley, Stephen. 2014. Hazlitt the Dissenter: Religion, Philosophy, and Politics, 1766-1816. London: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • A major study with an emphasis on the Dissenting tradition’s influence on Hazlitt’s early philosophical and political writing.
• Butler, Marilyn. 1981. Romantics, Rebels and Reactionaries: English Literature and its Background 1760-1830. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major work on the period, it includes a summary of Hazlitt’s career as a radical and characteristically English thinker. It puts the Romantic movement in its historical setting and emphasizes its contradictions.
• Cook, Jon. 2023. ‘Hazlitt’s First acquaintance with Poets’. The Hazlitt Review, 16, 33 – 47.
• Dart, Gregory. 2000. ‘Romantic Cockneyism: Hazlitt and the Periodical Press’. Romanticism 6.2, 143-62.
• Eagleton, Terry. 1973. ‘William Hazlitt: An Empiricist Radical’. New Blackfriars, 54, 108 – 117.
• Eagleton, Terry. 2009. ‘The Critic as Partisan: William Hazlitt’s Radical Imagination’. Harper’s Magazine, 318 (1907), 77 – 82.
• Gilmartin, Kevin. 1996. Print Politics: The Press and Radical Opposition in Early Nineteenth Century England. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Gilmartin, Kevin. 2015. William Hazlitt: Political Essayist. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A major study which makes a case for the centrality of Hazlitt’s political thought to his achievement as an essayist.
• Harling, Philip. 1997. ‘William Hazlitt and Radical Journalism’. Romanticism, 3.1, 53-65.
• Hunnekuhl, Philipp. 2017. ‘Hazlitt, Crabb Robinson, and Kant: 1806 and Beyond’. The Hazlitt Review, 10, 45 – 62.
• Johnston, Freya. 2018. ‘Keeping to William Hazlitt’, in Thinking through Style: Non-Fiction Prose of the Long Nineteenth Century. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Kinnaird, John. 1977. ‘Hazlitt, Keats, and the Poetics of Intersubjectivity’. Criticism, 19 (1), 1 – 16.
• Kinnaird, John. 1978. William Hazlitt: Critic of Power. New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Takes ‘power’ to be the unifying theme of Hazlitt’s works, in both its political sense and in the sense of creative energy.
• Lockridge, Laurence S. 1989. The Ethics of Romanticism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Chapter 7 is entitled ‘Hazlitt: Common Sense of a Dissenter.’
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 1995. ‘Hazlitt on the Future of the Self’, Journal of the History of Ideas, 56 (3), 463 – 81.
  • Makes a strong claim for the originality of Hazlitt’s theory of personal identity.
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 2003. ‘Self-Concern from Priestley to Hazlitt’. British Journal for the History of Philosophy,11(3), 499 – 507.
• McFarland, Thomas. 1987.  Romantic Cruxes: The English Essayists and the Spirit of the Age. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Mee, Jon. 2011. Conversable Worlds: Literature, Contention, and Community 1762 – 1830. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Michael, Timothy. 2024. ‘Hazlitt, Disinterestedness, and the Liberty of the Press’. The Review of English Studies, 75 (318), 57 – 74.
• Milnes, Tim. 2000. ‘Seeing in the Dark: Hazlitt’s Immanent Idealism’. Studies in Romanticism, 39 (1), 3 – 25.
• Milnes, Tim. 2003. Knowledge and Indifference in English Romantic Prose. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Milnes, Tim. 2017. ‘“This Happy Nonentity”: Hazlitt, Hume, and the Essay’. The Hazlitt Review, 10, 63 – 72.
• Milnes, Tim. 2019. The Testimony of Sense: Empiricism and the Essay from Hume to Hazlitt. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Mulvihill, James. 1990. ‘Hazlitt and “First Principles”’. Studies in Romanticism, 29 (2), 241 – 255.
• Natarajan, Uttara. 1996. ‘Abstracting Passion: Hazlitt’s Ideal of Power’. New Blackfriars, 77, 276 – 287.
• Natarajan, Uttara. 1998. Hazlitt and the Reach of Sense: Criticism, Morals, and the Metaphysics of Power. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • A major study, focusing on the innate, independent activity of the mind. It makes a case for the importance of the philosophy for the essays and criticism.
• Natarajan, Uttara, Paulin, Tom, Wu, Duncan (eds.). 2005. Metaphysical Hazlitt: Bicentenary Essays. London: Routledge.
  • Commemorates the bicentenary of Hazlitt’s Essay on the Principles of Human Action, with essays by important Hazlitt scholars and philosophers.
• Noxon, James. 1963. ‘Hazlitt as Moral Philosopher’. Ethics, 73 (4), 279 – 283.
• Park, Roy. 1971. Hazlitt and the Spirit of the Age: Abstraction and Critical Theory. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • An important study, relating Hazlitt’s literary works to his painting and to his philosophy, especially his concept of abstraction.
• Paulin, Tom. 1998. The Day-Star of Liberty: William Hazlitt’s Radical Style. London: Faber.
  • A passionate argument for Hazlitt’s status as a prose artist and political radical.
• Philp, Mark. 2020. Radical Conduct: Politics, Sociability and Equality in London 1789 – 1815. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Postle, Martin. 2015. ‘“Boswell Redivivus”: Northcote, Hazlitt, and the British School’. The Hazlitt Review, 8, 5 – 20.
• Rée, Jonathan. 2019. Witcraft: The Invention of Philosophy in English. London: Allen Lane.
  • As well as intellectual portraits of celebrated philosophers there is discussion of the philosophical work of literary authors. A section entitled ‘1801: Politics, Paradise and Personal Identity’ provides a lively narrative concerning Hazlitt’s family, influences, relationships and ideas.
• Schneider, Elisabeth W. 1933. The Aesthetics of William Hazlitt: A Study of the Philosophical Basis of his Criticism. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
• Tomalin, Marcus. 2012. Romanticism and Linguistic Theory: William Hazlitt, Language and Literature. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Wakefield, James. 2021. ‘On Whether William Hazlitt Was A Philosophical Idealist (and Why It Matters’). The Hazlitt Review,14, 5 – 23.
• Wellek, Rene. 1931. Immanuel Kant in England 1793 – 1838. Princeton, N.J: Princeton University Press.
• Whale, John. 2000. ‘Hazlitt and the Limits of the Sympathetic Imagination’, in Imagination under Pressure, 1789-1832: Aesthetics, Politics and Utility. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 110-39.
• Wu, Duncan. 2006. ‘Hazlitt’s Unpublished History of English Philosophy: The Larger Context’. The Library: The Transactions of the Bibliographical Society, 7(1), 25 -64.
• Other Resources:
• Keynes, Geoffrey. 1931. Bibliography of William Hazlitt. London: Nonesuch Press.
• Peter Landry’s Hazlitt Page: http://www.blupete.com/Literature/Essays/WorksHaz.htm.
• Romantic Circles: Home | Romantic Circles (romantic-circles.org).
• The Hazlitt Review, an annual peer-reviewed journal published by the Hazlitt Society.
• The Hazlitt Society: www.ucl.ac.uk/hazlitt-society.
• Other References:
• Lamb, Charles. 1980. Lamb as Critic. R. Park (ed.). London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
• Locke, John. 1975. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. P. H. Nidditch (ed.). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Martin, Raymond and Barresi, John. 2000. Naturalization of the Soul: Self and Personal Identity in the Eighteenth Century. London and New York: Routledge.
• Michael, Timothy. 2016. British Romanticism and the Critique of Political Reason. Baltimore, Md: John Hopkins University Press.
• Parfit, Derek. 1987. Reasons and Persons. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Reid, Thomas.1983. Inquiry and Essays. R. E. Beanblossom and K. Lehrer (eds.). Indianapolis, Ind.: Hackett Publishing Company.
• Strawson, Peter. 1964. Individuals: An Essay in Descriptive Metaphysics. London: Methuen University Paperback.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1958. The Blue and Brown Books. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.

 

Author Information

Graham Nutbrown
Email: gn291@bath.ac.uk
University of Bath
United Kingdom