The Brain in a Vat Argument

The Brain in a Vat thought-experiment is most commonly used to illustrate global or Cartesian skepticism. You are told to imagine the possibility that at this very moment you are actually a brain hooked up to a sophisticated computer program that can perfectly simulate experiences of the outside world. Here is the skeptical argument. If you cannot now be sure that you are not a brain in a vat, then you cannot rule out the possibility that all of your beliefs about the external world are false. Or, to put it in terms of knowledge claims, we can construct the following skeptical argument. Let “P” stand for any belief or claim about the external world, say, that snow is white.

1. If I know that P, then I know that I am not a brain in a vat
2. I do not know that I am not a brain in a vat
3. Thus, I do not know that P.

The Brain in a Vat Argument is usually taken to be a modern version of René Descartes’ argument (in the Meditations on First Philosophy) that centers on the possibility of an evil demon who systematically deceives us. The hypothesis was the premise behind the 1999 movie The Matrix, in which the entire human race has been placed into giant vats and fed a virtual reality at the hands of malignant artificial intelligence (our own creations, of course).

One of the ways some modern philosophers have tried to refute global skepticism is by showing that the Brain in a Vat scenario is not possible. In his Reason, Truth and History (1981), Hilary Putnam first presented the argument that we cannot be brains in a vat, which has since given rise to a large discussion with repercussions for the realism debate and for central theses in the philosophy of language and mind. As we shall see, however, it remains far from clear how exactly Putnam’s argument should be taken and what it actually proves.

Table of Contents

1. Skepticism and Realism
2. Putnam’s argument
3. Reconstructions of the Argument
4. Brains in a Vat and Self-Knowledge
5. Significance of the Argument
6. References and Further Reading

1. Skepticism and Realism

Putnam’s argument is designed to attack the possibility of global skepticism that is implied by metaphysical realism. Putnam defines metaphysical realism as the view which holds that “…the world consists of some fixed totality of mind-independent objects. There is exactly one true and complete description of ‘the way the world is.’ Truth involves some sort of correspondence relation between words or thought-signs and sets of things.” (1981, 49). This construal brings out the idea that for metaphysical realists, truth is not reducible to epistemic notions but concerns the nature of a mind-independent reality. This characterization finds an accurate target in those scientific materialists who believe in a “ready-made” world of scientific kinds independent of human classification and conceptualization. There are, however, many self-professed metaphysical realists who are not happy with Putnam’s definition; it saddles the realist with the classical difficulty of matching words to objects and of providing for a correspondence relation between sentences and mind-independent “facts.” The metaphysical realist is forced to construe her thesis ontologically, as an adherence to some fixed furniture of objects in the world, which ignores the possibility that ontological commitment may be specified not as a commitment to a set of entities but rather to the truth of a class of sentences or even of whole theories of the world.

One proposal is to construe metaphysical realism as the position that there are no a priori epistemically derived constraints on reality (Gaifman, 1993). By stating the thesis negatively, the realist sidesteps the thorny problems concerning correspondence or a “ready made” world, and shifts the burden of proof on the challenger to refute the thesis. One virtue of this construal is that it defines metaphysical realism at a sufficient level of generality to apply to all philosophers who currently espouse metaphysical realism. For Putnam’s metaphysical realist will also agree that truth and reality cannot be subject to “epistemically derived constraints.” This general characterization of metaphysical realism is enough to provide a target for the Brains in a Vat argument. For there is a good argument to the effect that if metaphysical realism is true, then global skepticism is also true, that is, it is possible that all of our referential beliefs about the world are false. As Thomas Nagel puts it, “realism makes skepticism intelligible,” (1986, 73) because once we open the gap between truth and epistemology, we must countenance the possibility that all of our beliefs, no matter how well justified, nevertheless fail to accurately depict the world as it really is. [See Fallibilism.] Donald Davidson also emphasizes this aspect of metaphysical realism: “metaphysical realism is skepticism in one of its traditional garbs. It asks: why couldn’t all my beliefs hang together and yet be comprehensively false about the actual world?” (1986, 309)

The Brain in a Vat scenario is just an illustration of this kind of global skepticism: it depicts a situation where all our beliefs about the world would presumably be false, even though they are well justified. Thus if one can prove that we cannot be brains in a vat, by modus tollens one can prove that metaphysical realism is false. Or, to put it in more schematic form:

1. If metaphysical realism is true, then global skepticism is possible
2. If global skepticism is possible, then we can be brains in a vat
3. But we cannot be brains in a vat
4. Thus, metaphysical realism is false (1,2,3)

This article focuses mostly on claim (3), although some philosophers question (2), believing there may be ways of presenting the skeptical thesis even while granting Putnam’s argument.

2. Putnam’s argument

The major premise that underwrites Putnam’s argument is what he calls a “causal constraint” on reference:

(CC) A term refers to an object only if there is an appropriate causal connection between that term and the object

To understand this criterion we need to unravel what is meant by “appropriate causal connection.” If an ant were to accidentally draw a picture of Winston Churchill in the sand, few would claim that the ant represented or referred to Churchill. Similarly, if I accidentally sneeze “Genghis Khan,” just because I verbalize the words does not mean that I refer to the infamous Mongolian conqueror, for I may have never heard of him before. Reference cannot simply be an accident: or, as Putnam puts it, words do not refer to objects “magically” or intrinsically. Now establishing just what would count as necessary and sufficient conditions for a term to refer to an object turns out to be tricky business, and there have been many “causal theories” of reference supplied to do just that. Many have taken the virtue of Putnam’s constraint (CC) to be its generality: it merely states a necessary condition for reference and need not entail anything more controversial. Sometimes it is claimed that endorsing (CC) commits you to semantic externalism but the issues are more complex, since many internalists (for example, John Searle) appear to agree with (CC). The relation between externalism and Putnam’s argument will be considered in more detail later (in the section “Brains in a Vat and Self-Knowledge”).

With the causal constraint established, Putnam goes on to describe the Brain in a Vat scenario. It is important to note exactly what the thought-experiment is, for failure to appreciate the ways in which Putnam has changed the standard skeptical nightmare has lead to many mistaken “refutations” of the argument. The standard picture has a mad-scientist (or race of aliens, or AI programs…) envatting brains in a laboratory then inducing a virtual reality through a sophisticated computer program. On this picture, there is an important difference between viewing the brains from a first or third person viewpoint. There is the point of view of the brains in a vat (henceforth BIVs), and the point of view of someone outside the vat. Clearly when the mad-scientist says “that is a brain in a vat” of a BIV, he would be saying something true, no matter the question of what the BIV means when it says it is a brain in a vat. Furthermore, presumably a BIV could pick up referential terms by borrowing them from the mad-scientist. Thus when a BIV says “there is a tree” referring to a simulation of a tree, it would be saying something false, since its term “tree,” picked up from the mad-scientist to refer to an actual tree, in fact refers to something else, like his sense-impressions of the tree. Putnam thus stipulates that all sentient beings are brains in a vat, hooked up to one another through a powerful computer that has no programmer: “that’s just how the universe is.” We are then asked, given at least the physical possibility of this scenario, whether we could say or think it. Putnam answers that we could not: the assertion “we are brains in a vat” would be sense self-refuting in the same way that the general statement “all general statements are false” is.

The thought-experiment stipulates that brains in a vat would have qualitatively identical thoughts to those unenvatted; or at least they have the same “notional world.” The difference is that in the vat-world, there are no external objects. When a BIV says “There is a tree in front of me,” there is in fact no tree in front of him, only a simulated tree produced by the computer’s program. However, if there are no trees, there could be no causal connection between a BIV’s tokens of trees and actual trees. By (CC), “tree” does not refer to tree. This leads to some interesting consequences.

A standard reading of a BIV’s utterance of “There is a tree” would have the statement come out false, since there are no trees for the BIV to refer to. But that would be only assuming that “tree” refers to tree in the BIV’s language. If “tree” does not refer to tree, then the semantic evaluation of the sentence becomes unclear. Sometimes Putnam suggests that a BIV’s tokens refer to images or sense-impressions. At other times he agrees with Davidson who claims that the truth-conditions would be facts about the electronic impulses of the computer that are causally responsible for producing the sense-impressions. Davidson has a good reason to choose these truth-conditions: through the principle of charity he would want to interpret the BIV’s sentences to come out true, but he would not want the truth-conditions to be phenomenalistic. Thus it turns out that when a BIV says “There is a tree in front of me,” he is saying something true—if in fact the computer is sending the right impulses to him.

Another suggestion is that the truth-conditions of the BIV’s utterances would be empty: the BIV asserts nothing at all. This seems to be rather strong, however: surely the BIV would mean something when it utters “There is a tree in front of me,” even if its statement gets evaluated differently because of the radical difference of its environment. One thing is clear, however; a BIV’s tokening of “tree” or any other such referential term would have a different reference assignment from that of a non-envatted person’s tokenings. According to (CC), my tokening of “tree” refers to trees because there is an appropriate causal link between it and actual trees (assuming of course I am not a BIV). A brain in a vat however would not be able to refer to trees since there are no trees (and even if there were trees there would not be the appropriate causal relation between its tokenings of “tree” and real trees, unless we bring back the standard fantasy and assume it picked up the terms from the mad scientist). Now one might be inclined to think that because there are at least brains and vats in the universe, a BIV would be able to refer to brains and vats. But the tokening of “brain” is never actually caused by a brain except only in the very indirect sense that its brain causes all of its tokenings. The minimal constraint (CC) then will ensure that “brain” and “vat” in the BIV language does not refer to brain and vat.

We are now in a position to give Putnam’s argument. It has the form of a conditional proof :

1. Assume we are brains in a vat
2. If we are brains in a vat, then “brain” does not refer to brain, and “vat” does not refer to vat (via CC)
3. If “brain in a vat” does not refer to brains in a vat, then “we are brains in a vat” is false
4. Thus, if we are brains in a vat, then the sentence “We are brains in a vat” is false (1,2,3)

Putnam adds that “we are brains in a vat” is necessarily false, since whenever we assume it is true we can deduce its contradictory. The argument is valid and its soundness seems to depend on the truth of (3), assuming (CC) is true. One immediate problem is determining the truth-conditions for “we are brains in a vat” on the assumption we are brains in a vat, speaking a variation of English (call it Vatese). From (CC) we know that “brains in a vat” does not refer to brain in a vat. But it doesn’t follow from this alone that “we are brains in a vat” is false. Compare:

(A) “Grass is green” is true iff grass is green
(B) “Grass is green” is true iff one has sense-impressions of grass being green
(C) “Grass is green” is true iff one is in electronic state Q

On the assumption that we are brains in a vat, (CC) would appear to rule out (A): “grass” does not refer to grass since there is no appropriate causal connection between “grass” and actual grass. Thus the truth-conditions for the statement “grass is green” would be nonstandard. If we take them to be those captured in (B), then “Grass is green” as spoken by a brain in a vat would be true. Consequently the truth-conditions for “we are brains in a vat” would be captured by (D):

(D) “We are brains in a vat” is true iff we have sense impressions of being brains in a vat

On this construal of the truth-conditions, “We are brains in a vat” as uttered by a BIV would presumably be false, since a brain in a vat would not have sense-impressions of being a brain in a vat: recall a BIV’s notional world would be equivalent to the unenvatted, and he would appear to himself to be a normally embodied person with a real body etc. However, if we follow Davidson and adopt the truth-conditions of (C), we would have the following:

(E) “We are brains in a vat” is true if and only if we are in electronic state Q

Now it is no longer clear that “We are brains in a vat” is false: for if the brain is in the appropriate electronic state, the truth-conditions could well be fulfilled. There are other reconstructions of the argument that do not depend on specifying the truth-conditions of a BIV’s utterances. What is important is the idea that the truth-conditions would be non-standard, as in:

(F) “We are brains in a vat” is true if and only if we are BIVs*

Now since being a BIV* (whatever that is) is not the same as being a BIV, we can construct the following conditional proof argument:

1. Assume we are BIVs
2. If we are BIVs, “we are brains in a vat” is true if and only we are BIVs*
3. If we are BIVs, we are not BIVs*
4. If we are BIVs, then “we are BIVs” is false (2,3)
5. If we are BIVs, then we are not BIVs (4)

Notice that the argument leaves the antecedent of the conditional open, what Wright calls an “open subjunctive.” We do not want the premises of the argument to be counterfactual, following the train of thought “If we were brains in a vat, the causal constraint would entail that my words ‘brain in a vat’ would come to denote something different, BIV*.” For then we would be assuming that we are not brains in a vat, when that is what the argument is supposed to prove.

Nevertheless, there are still problems with the appeal to disquotation to get us from (4) to (5). Even if, by virtue of the causal constraint, the sentence “We are BIVs” is false, an intuitive objection runs that this change of language should not entail falsity of the proposition that we are brains in a vat. As we shall see, many recent reconstructions of Putnam’s argument are sensitive to this point and try to account for it in various ways. In the following section, I shall focus on two of the more popular reconstructions of the argument put forward by Brueckner (1986) and Wright (1994).

3. Reconstructions of the Argument

Brueckner (1986) argues that even if we grant the reasoning of the above argument up to (4), the most the argument proves is that if we are brains in a vat, then the sentence “We are brains in a vat” (as uttered by a BIV) is false, and that if we are not brains in a vat, then “We are brains in a vat” is false (now expressing a different false proposition). If correct then the argument would prove that whether or not we are brains in a vat, “we are brains in a vat” expresses some false proposition. Assuming the truth-conditions of a BIV would be those captured in (D) we could then devise the following constructive dilemma type argument:

1. Either I am a BIV or I am not a BIV
2. If I am a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is true iff I have sense impressions of being a BIV
3. If I am a BIV, then I do not have sense-impressions of being a BIV
4. If I am a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is false (2,3)
5. If I am not a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is true iff I am a BIV
6. If I am not a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is false (5)
7. “I am a BIV” is false (1, 4, 6)

If “I am a BIV” expresses the proposition that I am a brain in a vat, and we know from the argument that “I am a BIV” is false, then it follows that I know I am not a brain in a vat, thus refuting premise (2) of the skeptical argument. However, can I know that “I am a brain in a vat” expresses the proposition that I am a brain in a vat? If I am a brain in a vat, then “I am a brain in a vat” would, via the causal constraint on reference, express some different proposition (say, that I am a brain in a vat in the image). So even if “I am a BIV” is false whether or not I am a BIV, I might not be in the position to identify which false proposition I am expressing, in which case I cannot claim to know that my sentence “I am not a brain in a vat” expresses the true proposition that I am not a brain in a vat.

Some philosophers have gone even further, claiming that if the argument ends here, it actually can be used to strengthen skepticism. The metaphysical realist can claim that there are truths not expressible in any language: perhaps the proposition that we are brains in a vat is true, even if no one can meaningfully utter it. As Nagel puts it:

If I accept the argument, I must conclude that a brain in a vat can’t think truly that it is a brain in a vat, even though others can think this about it. What follows? Only that I cannot express my skepticism by saying “Perhaps I am a brain in a vat.” Instead I must say “Perhaps I can’t even think the truth about what I am, because I lack the necessary concepts and my circumstances make it impossible for me to acquire them!” If this doesn’t qualify as skepticism, I don’t know what does. (Nagel, 1986)

Putnam makes it clear that he is not merely talking about semantics: he wants to provide a metaphysical argument that we cannot be brains in a vat, not just a semantic one that we cannot assert we are. If he is just proving something about meaning, it is open for the skeptic to say that the bonds between language and reality can diverge radically, perhaps in ways we can never discern.

There is yet another worry with the argument, centering once again on the appropriate characterization of the truth-conditions in (2). If one claimed in response to the above objection that in fact I do know that “I am a brain in a vat” expresses the proposition that I am a brain in a vat (whether or not I am a brain in a vat), one may have in mind some general disquotation principle:

(DQ): “Grass is green” is true iff grass is green

If it is an a priori truth that any meaningful sentence in my language homophonically disquotes, then we can a priori know that the following is also true:

(F): “I am a brain in a vat” is true iff I am a brain in a vat

Here is the obvious problem: if we are not to beg the question, we have to be open to the possibility that we are brains in a vat, speaking Vatese. Then we would get:

(G): If I am a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is true iff I am a brain in a vat.

However, (G) gives us truth-conditions that differ from premise (2) of Brueckner’s argument:

(2) If I am a BIV, then “I am a BIV” is true iff I have sense-impressions of being a BIV

If we assume (CC), then (G) and (2) are inconsistent, since the term “BIV” would refer to distinct entities. No contradiction ensues if we assume we are speaking in English: for then (G) would presumably be false (appealing to CC). But the problem is that we cannot beg the question by assuming we are speaking in English: if we assume that, then we know in advance of any argument that we are not speaking in Vatese and hence that we are not brains in a vat. But if we do not know which language we are speaking in, then we cannot properly assert (2).

One response to this is to formulate two different arguments, one whose meta-language is in English, the other whose meta-language is in Vatese, and show that distinct arguments can be run to prove that “I am a BIV” is false. Even if successful, however, these arguments run into the objection canvassed before: if I do not know which language I am speaking in, even if I know “I am a brain in a vat” is false, I do not know which false proposition I am expressing and hence cannot infer that I know that I am not a brain in a vat.

Similar worries plague Crispin’s Wright’s popular formulation of the argument (1994):

1. My language disquotes
2. In BIVese, “brains in a vat” does not refer to brains in a vat
3. In my language, “brains in a vat” is a meaningful expression
4. In my language, “brains in a vat” refers to brains in a vat
5. My language is not BIVese (2,4)
6. If I am a BIV, then my language is BIVese
7. I am not a BIV

There are several virtues to this reconstruction: first of all, it gets us to the desired conclusion without specifying what the truth-conditions of a BIV’s utterances would be. They could be sense-impressions, facts about electronic impulses, or the BIV’s sentences may not refer at all. All that is needed for the argument is that there is a difference between the truth-conditions for a BIV’s sentences and those of my own language. The other virtue of the argument is that it clearly brings out the appeal to the disquotation principle that was implicit in the previous arguments. If indeed (DQ) is an a priori truth, as many philosophers maintain, and if we accept (CC) as a condition of reference, the argument appears to be sound. So have we proven that we are not brains in a vat?

Not so fast. The previous objection can be restated: if I do not yet know whether or not I am a brain in a vat before the argument is completed, I do not know which language I am speaking (English or Vatese). If I am speaking Vatese, then so long as it is a meaningful language, I can appeal to disquotation to establish that “brains in a vat” does refer to brains in a vat. But this contradicts premise (2). The problem seems to be that (DQ) is being used too liberally. Clearly we do not want to say that every meaningful term disquotes in the strong sense required for reference. If so, we could take it to be an a priori truth that “Santa Claus” refers to Santa Claus. But “Santa Claus” does not refer to Santa Claus, since there is no Santa Claus. We could introduce a new term “pseudo-reference” and hold that “Santa Claus” pseudo-refers to Santa Claus, and then attach further conditions on reference in order to establish what it would take for the term to truly refer. One proposal (Weiss, 2000) is the following principle:

W: If “x” psuedo-refers to x in L, and x exists, then “x” refers to x in L

Thus, given the disquotation principle we know that in my language “Santa Claus” pseudo-refers to Santa Claus. Supposing to the joyful adulation of millions that Santa Claus is discovered to actually exist, then given (W) “Santa Claus” refers to Santa Claus. Now this also seems too simplistic: as Putnam pointed out, in order for a term to refer to an object we must establish more than the mere existence of the object. There has to be the appropriate causal relation between the word and object, or we are back to claiming that in accidentally sneezing “Genghis Khan” I am referring to Genghis Khan. But whether we accept (W) or attach stronger conditions to reference, it is clear that any such move would make Wright’s formulation invalid. For then we would have:

1. My language disquotes
2. In BIVese, “brains in a vat” does not refer to brains in a vat (CC)
3. In my language “brain in a vat” is a meaningful expression
4. In my language, “brain in a vat” pseudo-refers to brains in a vat (DQ)
5. My language is not BIVese (2,4)
6. If I am a BIV, then my language is BIVese
7. I am not a BIV

(5) no longer follows from (2) and (4) given the ambiguity of “refers” in (2) and (4). If on the other hand we insist on a univocal sense of reference, then either (2) will contradict the (DQ) principle, or we are not entitled to appeal to (1), insofar as it would beg the question that we are speaking English, a language for which the (DQ) principle applies.

4. Brains in a Vat and Self-Knowledge

Ted Warfield (1995) has sought to provide an argument that we are not brains in a vat based on considerations of self-knowledge. He defends two premises that seem reasonably true, and then he argues for the desired metaphysical conclusion:

1. I think that water is wet
2. No brain in a vat can think that water is wet
3. Thus, I am not a brain in a vat (2.3)

Premise (1) is said to follow from the thesis of privileged access, which holds that we can at least know the contents of our own occurring thoughts without empirical investigation of our environment or behavior. Warfield’s strategy is to present each premise as non-question begging against the global skeptic, in which case at no point can we appeal to the external environment as justification. Since the thesis of privileged access is said to be known a priori whether we are brains in a vat or not, premise (1) can be known non-empirically.

Premise (2) is a little trickier to establish non-empirically. The main argument for it is by analogy with other arguments in the literature that have been used to establish content externalism. The main strategy is derived from Putnam’s Twin Earth argument (1975): imagine a world that is indistinguishable from Earth except for one detail: the odorless, drinkable liquid that flows in the rivers and oceans is composed of the chemicals XYZ and not H20. If we take Oscar on Earth and his twin on Twin-earth, Putnam argues that they would refer to two different substances and hence mean two different things: when Oscar says “pass me some water” he refers to H20 and means water, but when Twin-Oscar says “pass me some water” he refers to XYZ and thus means twin-water. As Tyler Burge and others have pointed out, if the meaning of their words are different, then the concepts that compose their beliefs should differ as well, in which case Oscar would believe that water is wet whereas Twin-Oscar would believe that twin-water is wet. While Putnam’s original slogan was “meanings just ain’t in the head,” the argument can be extended to beliefs as well: “beliefs just ain’t in the head,” but depend crucially on the layout of one’s environment.

If we accept content externalism, then the motivation for (2) is as follows. In order for someone’s belief to be about water, there must be water in that person’s environment: externalism rejects the Cartesian idea that one can simply read off one’s belief internally (if so then we would have to say that Oscar and his twin have the same beliefs since they are internally the same). So it doesn’t seem possible that a BIV could ever come to hold a belief about water (unless of course he picked up the term from the mad-scientist or someone outside the vat, but here we must assume again Putnam’s scenario that there is no mad-scientist or anyone else he could have borrowed the term from). As Warfield puts it, premise (2) is a conceptual truth, established on the basis of Twin-earth style arguments, a matter of “armchair” a priori reflection and thus able to be established non-empirically.

The problem with establishing (2) non-empirically though is that the externalist arguments succeed only on the assumption that our own use of “water” refers to a substantial kind, and this seems to be a matter of empirical investigation. Imagine a world where “water” does not refer to any liquid substance but is rather a complex hallucination that never gets discovered. On this “Dry Earth,” “water” would not refer to a substantial kind but rather a superficial kind. The analogy to the BIV case is clear: since it is not an a priori truth that “water” refers to a substantial kind in the BIV’s language, it cannot be known non-empirically that “water” is substantial or superficial; if it is a superficial kind, then a BIV could very well think that water is wet so long as it has the relevant sense-impressions.

5. Significance of the Argument

Some philosophers have claimed that even if Putnam’s argument is sound, it doesn’t do much to dislodge Cartesian or global skepticism. Crispin Wright (1994) argues that the argument does not affect certain versions of the Cartesian nightmare, such as my brain being taken out of my skull last night and hooked up to a computer. Someone of a Positivist bent might argue that if there is no empirical evidence to appeal to in order to establish whether we are brains in a vat or not, then the hypothesis is meaningless, in which case we do not need an argument to refute it. While few philosophers today would hold onto such a strong verifiability theory of meaning, many would maintain that such metaphysical possibilities do not amount to real cases of doubt and thus can be summarily dismissed. Still others see the possibility of being a brain in a vat an important challenge for cognitive science and the attempt to create a computer model of the world that can simulate human cognition. Dennett (1991) for example has argued that it is physically impossible for a brain in a vat to replicate the qualitative phenomenology of a non-envatted human being. Nevertheless, one should hesitate before making possibility claims when it comes to future technology. And as films like the Matrix, Existenz, and even the Truman Show indicate, the idea of living in a simulated world indistinguishable from the real one is likely to continue to fascinate the human mind for many years to come—whether or not it is a brain in a vat.

6. References and Further Reading

• Boghossian, Paul. 1999. What the Externalist can Know A Priori. Philosophical Issues 9
• Brueckner, Anthony. 1986. Brains in a Vat. Journal of Philosophy 83: 148-67
• Brueckner, Anthony. 1992. If I am a Brain in a vat, then I am not a Brain in a Vat. Mind 101:123-128
• Burge, T. 1982. Other Bodies. In A. Woodfield. Ed., Thought and Object: Essays on Intentionality. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 91-120.
• Casati, R. and Dokic J. 1991. Brains in a Vat, Language and Metalanguage. Analysis 51: 91-93.
• Collier, J. 1990. Could I Conceive Being a Brain in a Vat? Australasian Journal of Philosophy 68: 413-419.
• Davidson, Donald. 1986. “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge,” in Truth and Interpretation: Perspectives on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Davies, D. 1995. Putnam’s Thought-Teaser. Canadian Journal of Philosophy 25(2):203-227.
• Ebbs, G. (1992), “Skepticism, Objectivity and Brains in Vats”, Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 73
• Forbes, G. 1995. Realism and Skepticism: Brains in a Vat Revisited. Journal of Philosophy 92(4): 205-222
• Gaifman, Haim. 1994. Metaphysical Realism and Vats in a Brain. (unpublished ms)
• Nagel, Thomas. 1986. The View from Nowhere. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Noonan, Harold. 1998. Reflections on Putnam, Wright and brains in a vat. Analysis 58:59-62
• Putnam, Hilary 1975. The Meaning of “Meaning.” Mind, Language and Reality: Philosophical Papers, Vol 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
• Putnam, Hilary. 1982. Reason, Truth and History. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Putnam, Hilary. 1994. Reply to Wright. In P. Clark and B. Hale, eds. Reading Putnam. Oxford, Blackwell.
• Sawyer, Sarah. 1999. My Language Disquotes. Analysis, vol. 59:3: 206-211
• Smith, P. (1984), Could We Be Brains in a Vat?, Canadian Journal of Philosophy 14
• Steinitz, Y. Brains in a vat? Different Perspectives. Philosophical Quarterly 44 (175): 213-222
• Tymoczko, T. 1989. In Defense of Putnam’s Brains. Philosophical Studies 57(3) 281-297
• Warfield, Ted. 1995. Knowing the World and Knowing our Minds. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 55 (3): 525-545.
• Weiss, B. 2000. Generalizing Brains in a Vat. Analysis 60: 112-123
• Wright, Crispin. 1994. On Putnam’s Proof that we cannot be brains in a vat. In P. Clark and B. Hale. Eds, Reading Putnam. Oxford: Blackwell.

Author Information

Lance P. Hickey
Email: lance1001@optonline.net
Southern Connecticut State University
U. S. A.

Fallibilism

Fallibilism is the epistemological thesis that no belief (theory, view, thesis, and so on) can ever be rationally supported or justified in a conclusive way. Always, there remains a possible doubt as to the truth of the belief. Fallibilism applies that assessment even to science’s best-entrenched claims and to people’s best-loved commonsense views. Some epistemologists have taken fallibilism to imply skepticism, according to which none of those claims or views are ever well justified or knowledge. In fact, though, it is fallibilist epistemologists (which is to say, the majority of epistemologists) who tend not to be skeptics about the existence of knowledge or justified belief. Generally, those epistemologists see themselves as thinking about knowledge and justification in a comparatively realistic way — by recognizing the fallibilist realities of human cognitive capacities, even while accommodating those fallibilities within a theory that allows perpetually fallible people to have knowledge and justified beliefs. Still, although that is the aim of most epistemologists, the question arises of whether it is a coherent aim. Are they pursuing a coherent way of thinking about knowledge and justification? Much current philosophical debate is centered upon that question. Epistemologists generally seek to understand knowledge and justification in a way that permits fallibilism to be describing a benign truth about how we can gain knowledge and justified beliefs. One way of encapsulating that project is by asking whether it is possible for a person ever to have fallible knowledge and justification.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Formulating Fallibilism: Preliminaries
3. Formulating Fallibilism: A Thesis about Justification
4. Formulating Fallibilism: Necessary Truths
5. Empirical Evidence of Fallibility
6. Philosophical Sources of Fallibilism: Hume
7. Philosophical Sources of Fallibilism: Descartes
8. Implications of Fallibilism: No Knowledge?
9. Implications of Fallibilism: Knowing Fallibly?
10. Implications of Fallibilism: No Justification?
11. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The term “fallibilism” comes from the nineteenth century American philosopher Charles Sanders Peirce, although the basic idea behind the term long predates him. According to that basic idea, no beliefs (or opinions or views or theses, and so on) are so well justified or supported by good evidence or apt circumstances that they could not be false. Fallibilism tells us that there is no conclusive justification and no rational certainty for any of our beliefs or theses. That is fallibilism in its strongest form, being applied to all beliefs without exception. In principle, it is also possible to be a restricted fallibilist, accepting a fallibilism only about some narrower class of beliefs. For example, we might be fallibilists about whatever beliefs we gain through the use of our senses — even while remaining convinced that we possess the ability to reason in ways that can, at least sometimes, manifest infallibility. Thus, one special case of this possible selectivity would have us being fallibilists about empirical science even while exempting mathematical reasoning from that verdict. For simplicity, though (and because it represents the thinking of most epistemologists), in what follows I will generally discuss fallibilism in its unrestricted form. (The exception will be section 6, where a particularly significant, but seemingly narrower, form of fallibilism will be presented.)

Fallibilism is an epistemologically pivotal thesis, and our initial priority must be to formulate it carefully. Almost all contemporary epistemologists will say that they are fallibilists. Yet the vast majority of them also wish not to be skeptics. They would rather not be committed to embracing principles about the nature of knowledge and justification which commit them to denying that there can be any knowledge or justified belief. This desire coexists, nonetheless, with the belief that fallibility is rampant. Many epistemological debates, it transpires, can be understood in terms of how they try to balance these epistemologically central desires. So, can we find a precise philosophical understanding of ourselves as being perpetually fallible even though reassuringly rational and, for the most part, knowledgeable?

2. Formulating Fallibilism: Preliminaries

An initial statement of fallibilism might be this:

All beliefs are fallible. (No belief is infallible.)

But what, exactly, is that saying? Here are three claims it is not making.

(1) Fallible people. It is not saying just that all believers — all people — are fallible. A person as such is fallible if, at least sometimes, he is capable of forming false beliefs. But that is compatible with the person’s often — on some other occasions — believing infallibly. And that is not a state of affairs which is compatible with fallibilism.

(2) Actually false beliefs. Nor is fallibilism the thesis that in fact all beliefs are false. That possibility is allowed — but it is not required — by fallibilism. Hence, it is false to portray fallibilism — as commentators on science, in particular, sometimes do — in these terms:

All scientific beliefs are false. This includes all scientific theories, of course. (After all, even scientific theories are only theories. So they are fallible — and therefore false.)

Regardless of whether or not that is a correct claim about scientific beliefs and theories, it is not an accurate portrayal of what fallibilism means to say. The key term in fallibilism, as we have so far formulated it, is “fallible.” And this conveys — through its use of “-ible” — only some kind of possibility of falsity, rather than the definite presence of actual falsity.

(3) Contingent truths. Take the belief that there are currently at least one thousand kangaroos alive in Australia. That belief is true, although it need not have been. It could have been false — in that the world need not have been such as to make it true. So, the belief is only contingently true (as philosophers say). By definition, any contingent truth could have failed to be true. But even if we were to accept that all truths are only contingently true, we would not be committed to fallibilism. The recognition that contingent truths exist is not what underlies fallibilism. The claim that any contingent truth could instead have been false is not the fallibilist claim, because fallibilism is not a thesis about truths in themselves. Instead, it is about our attempts in themselves to accept or believe truths. It concerns a kind of fundamental limitation first and foremost upon our powers of rational thought and representation. And although a truth’s being contingent means that it did not have to be true, this does not mean that it will, or even that it can, be altering its truth-value (by becoming false) in such a way as to deceive you. For instance, the truth that there are now more than one thousand kangaroos alive in Australia is not made false even by there being only five kangaroos alive in Australia in two days time from now.

3. Formulating Fallibilism: A Thesis about Justification

Given section 2’s details, a better (and routine) expression of fallibilism is this:

F: All beliefs are only, at best, fallibly justified.

F’s main virtue, as a formulation of fallibilism, is its locating the culprit fallibility as arising within the putative justification that is present on behalf of a given belief. The kind of justification in question is called “epistemic justification” by epistemologists. And the suggested formulation, F, of fallibilism is saying that there is never conclusive justification for the truth of a given belief.

There are competing epistemological theories of what, exactly, epistemic justification is. Roughly speaking, though, it is whatever would make a belief more, rather than less, rationally well supported or established. This sort of rationality is meant to be truth-directed. For example (as Conee and Feldman 2004 would argue), whenever some evidence is providing epistemic support — justification — for a belief, this is a matter of its supporting the truth of that belief. In that sense, the evidence provides good reason to adopt the belief — to adopt it as true. Or (to take another example, such as would be approved of by the kind of theory from Goldman 1979) a believer might have formed her belief within some circumstance or in some way that — regardless of whether she can notice this — makes her belief likely to be true. (And when are these kinds of justificatory support present? In particular, are they only ever present if they are guaranteeing that the belief being supported is true? Are any actually false beliefs ever justified? Section 10 will focus on the question of whether fallible justification is ever present, either for true or for false beliefs.)

Just as there are competing interpretations of the nature of epistemic justification, epistemologists exercise care in how they read F. Perhaps the most natural reading of it says that no one is ever so situated — even when possessing evidence in favor of the truth of a particular belief — that, if she were to be rational in the sense of respecting and understanding and responding just to that evidence, she could not proceed to doubt that the belief is true. More generally, the idea behind F is that, no matter how good one’s justification is in support of a particular belief’s being true, that justification is never so good as to be conclusive — leaving no room for anyone who might be rationally attending to that justification not to have the belief it is supporting. At any stage, according to F, doubt could sensibly (in some relevant sense of “sensibly”) arise as to the truth of the particular belief.

Often, therefore, this kind of possible doubt is called a rational doubt. This is not to say that, necessarily, the most rational reaction is to be swayed by the doubt, accepting it as decisive; whether one should react like that is a separate issue, probably deserving to be decided only after some subtle argument. The term “rational doubt” is meant only to distinguish this sort of actual or possible doubt from a patently irrational one — a doubt that is psychologically, but not even prima facie rationally, available. How might a doubt that is not even prima facie rational arise? Here is one possible way. Imagine a person who is attending to evidence for the truth of a particular belief, yet who refuses to accept the belief’s being true. Suppose that this refusal is due either (i) to her misunderstanding the evidence or (ii) to some psychological quirk such as a general lack of respect for evidence at all or such as mere obstinacy (without her supplying counter-reasons disputing the truth or power of the evidence). There is no accounting for why some people will in fact doubt a given belief: psychologically, doubt could be an option even in the face of rationally conclusive evidence. Nevertheless, fallibilism is not a thesis about that psychological option. The option it describes concerns rationality. Fallibilism is about what it claims to be the ever-present availability of rational doubt.

Accordingly, one possible way of misinterpreting F would involve confusing the concept of a rational doubt with that of a subjectively felt doubt or, maybe more generally, a psychologically present doubt. Rational doubts need not be psychologically actual doubts, just as psychologically actual ones need not be rational. In theory, a person might have or feel some doubt as to whether a particular claim is true — some doubt which she should not have or feel. (Perhaps she is misevaluating the strength of the evidence she has in support of that claim.) Equally, someone might have or feel no doubt as to the truth of a belief he has — when he should have or feel some such doubt. (Perhaps he, too, is misevaluating the strength of the evidence he has in support of his belief.) In either case, the way in which the person is in fact reacting — by having, or by not having, an actual doubt — does not determine whether his or her evidence is in fact providing rationally conclusive support. That is because a particular reaction — of doubting or of not doubting — might not be as justified or rational in itself as is possible. (By analogy, we may keep in mind the case — unfortunately, all too common a kind of case — of a brutal tyrant who claims, sincerely, to have a clear conscience at the end of his life. The morality of his actions is more obviously to be explicated in terms of what his conscience should be telling him rather than of what it is telling him.) In effect, F is saying that no matter what evidence you have, no matter how carefully you have accumulated it, and no matter how rationally you use and evaluate it, you can never thereby have conclusive justification for a belief which you wish to support via all that evidence. Equally, F is saying that no matter what circumstance you occupy, and no matter how you are forming a particular belief, no guarantee is thereby being provided of your belief being true. In those respects (according to F), any justification you have is fallible — and it will remain so, no matter what you do with it, no matter how assiduously you attend to it, no matter what the circumstances are in which you are operating. The problem will also remain, no matter how you might supplement or try to improve your evidence or circumstances. Any possible addition or alteration that you might make will continue leaving open at least a possibility — one to which a careful and rational thinker would in principle respond respectfully if she were to notice it — of your belief’s being false.

In that way, fallibilism — as a thesis about justification — travels more deeply into the human cognitive condition than it would do if it were a point merely about logic, say. It is not saying that no belief is ever supported by evidence whose content logically entails the first belief’s content. An example of that situation would be provided by a person’s having, as evidence, the belief that he is a living, breathing Superman — from which he infers that he is alive. The evidence’s content (“I am a living, breathing Superman”) does logically entail the truth of the inferred content (“I am alive”). (This attribution of logical validity or entailment means — from standard deductive logic — that it is impossible for the first content to be true without the second one also being true.) But the justification being supplied is fallible, because — obviously — the person will have, at best, inconclusive justification for thinking that he is a living, breathing Superman in the first place. The putative justification is the belief (about being Superman) and its history, not only its content and the associated logical relations. Yet fallibilism says that, even when all such further features are taken into account, some potential will remain for rational doubt to be present.

4. Formulating Fallibilism: Necessary Truths

Nevertheless, a modification of F (in section 3) is required, it seems, if fallibilism is to apply to beliefs like mathematical ones or to beliefs reporting theses of pure logic, for instance. Most philosophers would accept that it is possible to be fallible in holding such a belief — and that this is so, even given that there is a sense in which such a belief, when true, could not ever be false. Thus, perhaps mathematical believing is a fallible process, able to lead to false beliefs. Perhaps this is so, even if mathematical truths themselves never “just happen” to be true — never depending upon changeable surrounding circumstances for their truth, hence never being susceptible to being rendered false by some change in those surrounding circumstances. How should we modify F, therefore, so as to understand the way in which fallibility can nonetheless be present in such a case? More generally, how should we modify F, so as to understand the prospect of a person ever having fallible beliefs (let alone only fallible ones) in what philosophers call necessary truths?

By definition, any truth which is not contingent is necessary. The class of necessary truths is the class of propositions or contents which, necessarily, are true. They could not have failed to be true. And that class will generally be thought to contain — maybe most significantly — mathematical truths. Consider, then, the belief that 2 + 2 = 4. In itself (almost every philosopher will concur), there is no possibility of that belief’s being false. However, if it is impossible for that belief to be false, then there is also no possible evidence on the basis of which — in coming to believe that 2 + 2 = 4 — a person could be forming a false belief. In this way, no belief that 2 + 2 = 4 could be merely fallibly justified — at least as this phenomenon has been portrayed in F. Yet it is clear — or so most epistemologists will aver — that mathematical believing can be fallible. Indeed, if fallibilism is true, all mathematical beliefs will be subject to some sort of fallibility: even mathematical beliefs would, at best, be only fallibly justified. How, therefore, is this to be understood?

Here is one suggestion — F* — which modifies F by drawing upon some standard epistemological thinking. The aim in moving from F to F* would be to allow for the possibility of having a fallible belief in a necessary truth:

F*: All beliefs are, at best, only fallibly justified. (And a belief is fallibly justified when — even if the belief, considered in itself, could not be false — the justification for it exemplifies or reflects some more general way or process of thinking or forming beliefs, a way or process which is itself fallible due to its capacity to result in false beliefs.)

Sections 5 and 7 will describe a few possible reasons for a fallibilist to regard your belief that 2 + 2 = 4 as being fallible. In the meantime, we need only note schematically how F* would accommodate those possible reasons. The basic approach would be as follows. Although your belief that 2 + 2 = 4 cannot be false (once it is present), your supposed justification for it is fallible. This could be so in a few ways. For a start, maybe you are merely repeating by rote something you were told many years ago by a somewhat unreliable school teacher. (Imagine the teacher having been poor at making accurate claims within most other areas of mathematics. Even with respect to the elements of mathematics about which she was accurate, she might have been merely repeating by rote what she had been told by her own early — and similarly unreliable — teachers.) The fallibility of memory is also relevant: over the years, one forgets much. Still, your current belief that 2 + 2 = 4 seems accurate. And it need not be present only because of your fallible memory of what your fallible teacher told you. Suppose that you are now very sophisticated in your mathematical thinking: in particular, your justification for your belief that 2 + 2 = 4 is purely mathematical in content. That justification involves clever representation, via precisely defined symbols, of abstract ideas. Nevertheless, even such purely mathematical reasoning can mislead you (no matter that it has not done so on this occasion). Really proving that 2 + 2 = 4 is quite difficult; and when people are seeking to grasp and to implement such proofs, human fallibility may readily intrude. Actual attempts to establish mathematical truths need not always lead to accurate or true beliefs.

At any rate, that is how a fallibilist might well analyze the case.

5. Empirical Evidence of Fallibility

How can we ascertain which of our ways of thinking are fallible? Both ordinary observation and sophisticated empirical research are usually regarded as able to help us here, by revealing some of the means by which fallibility enters our cognitive lives. I will list several of the seemingly fallible means of belief-formation and belief-maintenance that have been noticed.

(1) Misusing evidence. Apparently, people often misevaluate the strength of their evidence. By taking it to be stronger or weaker support than in fact it is for the truth of a particular belief, a person could easily be led to adopt or retain a false, rather than true, belief. Indeed, there are many possible ways not to use evidence properly. For example, people do not always notice, let alone compare and resolve, conflicting pieces of evidence. They might overlook some of the evidence available to them. There can be inattention to details of their evidence. And so forth.

(2) Unreliable senses. How many of us have wholly reliable — always accurate — senses? Shortsightedness is not so rare. The same is true of long-sightedness. People can have poor hearing, not to mention less-than-perfectly discerning senses of smell, taste, and so on. Sensory illusions and hallucinations affect us, too. The road seems to ripple under the heat of the sun; the stick appears to bend as it enters the glass of water; and so forth. In such cases we will think, upon reflection, that what we seem to sense is something we only seem to sense.

(3) Unreliable memory. At times, people suffer lapses of memory; and they can realize this, experiencing “blanks” as they endeavor to recall something. They can also feel as though they are remembering something, when actually this feeling is inaccurate. (A “false memory” is like that. The event which a person seems to recall, for instance, never actually happened.)

(4) Reasoning fallaciously. To reason in a logically invalid way is to reason in a way which, even given the truth of one’s premises or evidence, can lead to falsity. It is thereby to reason fallibly. Do we often reason like that? Seemingly, yes. Of course, often we and others realize that we are doing so. And we and those others might generally be satisfied with our admittedly fallible reasoning. (But should we ever regard it with satisfaction? Section 10 will consider this kind of question.) There are times, though, when we and others do not notice the fallibility in our reasoning. On those occasions, we are — without realizing this about ourselves — reasoning fallaciously. That is, we are reasoning in ways which are logically invalid but which most people mistakenly, albeit routinely, regard as being logically valid.

(5) Intelligence limitations. Is each of us so intelligent as never to make mistakes which a more intelligent person would be less likely (all else being equal) to make? Presumably none of us escape that limitation. Do we notice people making mistakes due to their exercising (and perhaps possessing) less intelligence than was needed not to make those mistakes? We appear to do so. Sometimes (often too late), we observe this in ourselves, too.

(6) Representational limitations. We use language and thought to represent or describe reality — hopefully, to do this accurately. But people have often, we believe, made mistakes about the world around them because of inadequacies in their representational or descriptive resources. For example, they can have been applying misleading and clumsily constructed concepts — ones which could well be replaced within an improved science. (And this sort of problem — at least to judge by the apparent inescapability of disputes among its practitioners — might be even more acute within such areas of thought as philosophy.)

(7) Situational limitations. It is not uncommon for people to make mistakes of fact because they have biases or prejudices that impede their ability to perceive or represent or reflect accurately upon those facts. Such mistakes may be made when people are manifesting an insufficiently developed awareness of pertinent aspects of the world. Maybe a person’s early upbringing, and how she has subsequently lived her life, has not exposed her to a particularly wide range of ideas. Perhaps she has not encountered what are, as it happens, more accurate ideas or principles than the ones she is applying in her attempts to understand the world. All of this might well prevent her even noticing some relevant aspects of the world. (When both I and a doctor gaze at an X-ray, only one of us notices much of medical relevance.)

That list of realistically possible sources of fallibility — philosophers will suspect — could be continued indefinitely. And its scope is disturbingly expansive. Thus, even when you do not feel as though a belief of yours has been formed or maintained in some way that manifests any of those failings, you could be mistaken about that. This is a factual matter; or so most philosophers will say. On any given occasion, it is an empirical question as to whether in fact you are being fallible in one of those ways. (Notably, it is not simply a matter of whether you are feeling fallible.) Accordingly, many epistemologists have paid attention to pertinent empirical research by psychiatrists, neurologists, biologists, anthropologists, and the like, into actual limitations upon human cognitive powers. Data uncovered so far have unveiled the existence of much fallibility. (See, for example, Nisbett and Ross 1980; Kahneman, Slovic, and Tversky 1982.)

Some epistemologists have found this to be worrying in itself. Still, has enough fallibility thereby been uncovered to justify an acceptance of fallibilism? (Remember that fallibilism, in its most general form, is the thesis that all of our beliefs are fallible.) This, too, is at least partly an empirical question. It is the question of just how fallible people are as a group — and, naturally, of just how much a given individual ever manages to transcend such limitations upon people in general. How fallibly, as it happens, do people ever form and maintain beliefs? Is every single one of us fallible enough to render every single one of our beliefs fallible?

It is difficult, perhaps impossible, to use personal observations and empirical research to answer those questions conclusively. (And fallibilism would deny that this is possible anyway.) For presumably such fallibilities would also afflict people as observers and as scientific inquirers. Hence, this would occur even when theorists — let alone casual observers — are investigating those fallibilities. The history of science reveals that many scientific theories which were at one time considered to be true have subsequently been supplanted, with later theories deeming the earlier ones to have been false.

Is science therefore especially fallible as a way of forming beliefs about the world? That is a matter of some philosophical dispute. Empirical science is performed by fallible people, often involving much fallible coordination among themselves. It relies on the fallible process of observation. And it can generate quite complicated theories and beliefs — with that complexity affording scope for marked fallibility. Yet in spite of these sources of fallibility nestling within it (when it is conceived of as a method), science might well (when it is conceived of as a body of theses and doctrines) encompass the most cognitively impressive store of knowledge that humans have ever amassed. Even if not all of its theories and beliefs are true (and therefore not all of them are knowledge), a significant percentage of them seem to have a strong case for being knowledge. Is that compatible with science’s fallibility, even its inherent fallibility, as a method? Or are none of its theories and beliefs knowledge, simply because (as later scientists will realize) some of them are not? Alternatively, are none of them knowledge, because none of them are conclusively justified? That depends on what kind of knowledge scientific knowledge would be. This is a subtle matter, asking us first to consider in general whether there can be inconclusively justified knowledge at all. Section 9 will indicate how epistemologists might take a step towards answering that question. It will do so by discussing the idea of fallible knowledge. (And section 10 will comment on science and fallible justification.)

6. Philosophical Sources of Fallibilism: Hume

Section 5 indicated some empirical grounds on which fallibilism might be thought to be true. Epistemologists have also provided non-empirical arguments for fallibilism, both in its strongest form and in important-but-weaker forms. This section and the next will present two of those arguments.

One of them comes from the eighteenth-century Scottish philosopher David Hume’s classic invention of what is now called inductive skepticism. (For a succinct version of his argument, see his 1902 [1748], sec. IV. For some sense of the philosophical and historical dimensions of that notion, see Buckle 2001: part 2, ch. 4.) At the core of his skeptical argument was an important-even-if-possibly-not-wholly-general fallibilism. Hume’s argument showed, at the very least, the inescapable fallibility of an extremely significant kind of belief — any belief which either is or could be an inductive extrapolation from observational data. According to Hume, no beliefs about what is yet to be observed (by a particular person or some group) can be infallibly established on the basis of what has been observed (by that person or that group). Consider any use of present and past observations, perhaps to derive and at least to support, some view that aims to describe aspects of the world that have not yet been observed. (Standard examples include people’s seeking to justify the belief that the sun will rise tomorrow, by using past observations of it having risen, and people’s many observations of black ravens supposedly justifying the belief that all ravens are black.) Hume noticed that observations can never provide conclusive assurance — a proof — that the world is not about to change from what it has thus far been observed to be like. Even if all observed Fs have been Gs, say, this does not entail that any, let alone all, of the currently unobserved Fs are also Gs. No such guarantee can be given by the past observations. And this is so, no matter how many observations of Fs have been made (short of having observed all of them, while realizing that this has occurred).

Hume presents his argument as one that uncovers a limitation upon the power or reach of reason — that is, upon how much can be revealed to us by reason as such. Possibly, this is in part because that is the non-trivial aspect of his argument. Overall, his argument is describing a limitation upon the power or reach both of reason and of observation — upon how far these faculties or capacities can take us towards proving the truth of various beliefs which, inevitably, we find ourselves having. But that limitation reflects both a point that is non-trivially true (about reason) and one that is trivially true (about observation). Hume combines those two points (as follows) to attain his fallibilism. (1) It is trivially true that any observations that have been made at and before a given time have not been of what, at that time, is yet to be observed. (2) It is true (although not trivially so) that our powers of reason face a limitation of their own, one that leaves them unable to overcome (1)’s limitation upon observation. Our capacity to reason — our powers simply of reflection — must concede that, regardless of however unlikely this might seem at the time, the unobserved Fs could be different in a relevant way from those that have been observed. Hence, in particular, whatever powers of reason we might use in seeking to move beyond our observations will be unable to eliminate the possibility that the presently unobserved Fs are quite different (as regards being Gs) from the Fs that have been observed. Our powers of reason must concede — again, even if this seems unlikely at the time — that continued observations of Fs might be about to begin giving results that are quite different to what such observations have previously revealed about Fs being Gs. Obviously, the past observations of Fs (all of which, we are supposing, were Gs) do not tell us that this is likely to occur, let alone that it is about to do so. But, crucially, pure reason tells us that it could be about to occur. (3) Consequently, if we combine (1) and (2), we reach this result:

Neither observation nor reason can reveal with rational certainty anything about the nature of any of the Fs that are presently unobserved.

In other words, there is always a “logical gap” between the observations of Fs that have been made (either by some individual or a group) and any conclusion regarding Fs that have not yet been observed (by either that individual or that group).

Our appreciation of that gap’s existence is made specific — even dramatic — by the Humean thought that the world could be about to change in the relevant respect. We thus see that fallibility cannot be excluded from any justification which we might think is present for a belief that either is or could be an extrapolation from some observations. Such a belief could be about the future (“The sun will rise tomorrow”), the presently unobserved past (“Dinosaurs used to live here”), populations (“The cats in this neighborhood are vicious”), and so on. Beliefs like that are pivotal in our mental lives, it seems.

Indeed, as some philosophers argue, they can be all-but-ubiquitous — even surprisingly so. When you believe that you are seeing a cat, is this an extrapolation from observations? At first glance, it seems straightforwardly observational itself. Yet maybe it is an extrapolation in a less obvious way. Perhaps it is an extrapolation from both your present sensory experience and similar ones that you have had in the past. Perhaps it is implicitly a prediction that the object in front of you is not about to begin looking and acting like a dog, and that it will continue looking and acting like a cat. (Is this part of what it means to say that the object is a cat — a genuine-flesh-and-blood-physical-object cat?) Are even simple observational beliefs therefore concealed or subtle extrapolations? If they are to be justified, will this need to be inductive justification?

If so, the Humean verdict (when formulated in contemporary epistemological language) remains that, even at best, such beliefs are only fallibly justified. Any justification for them would need to be observations from which they might have been extrapolated (even if in fact this is not, psychologically speaking, how they were reached). And no such justification could ever rationally eliminate the possibility that any group of apparently supportive observations is misleading as to what the world would be found to be like if further observations were to be made.

That is Hume’s inductive fallibilism — a fallibilism about all actual or possible inductive extrapolations from observations. Many interpreters believe that his argument established — or at least that Hume meant it to establish — more than a kind of fallibilism. This is why it is generally called an argument for inductive skepticism, not just for inductive fallibilism. (On Hume’s transition from fallibilism to skepticism, see Stove 1973.) Accordingly, his conclusion is sometimes presented more starkly, as saying that observations never rationally show or establish or support or justify at all any extrapolations beyond observational data, even ones that purport only to describe a likelihood of some observed pattern’s being perpetuated. At its most combative, his conclusion might be said — and sometimes is, especially by non-philosophers — to reveal that predictions are rationally useless or untenable, or that any beliefs “going beyond” observational reports are, rationally speaking, nothing more than guesses. Whether or not that skeptical thesis is true depends, for a start, upon whether there can be such a thing as fallible justification — or whether, once fallibility is present, justification departs. Section 10 will consider that issue.

In any case, Hume’s fallibilism is generally considered by philosophers (for instance, see Quine 1969; Miller 1994: 2-13; Howson 2000: ch. 1) to have struck a serious blow against the otherwise beguiling picture of science as delivering conclusive knowledge of the inner continuing workings of the world. It is not uncommon for people to react to this interpretation of Hume’s result by inferring that therefore science — with its reliance upon observations as data, with which it supports its predictions and more general principles and posits — never really gives us knowledge of a world beyond those observations. The appropriateness of that skeptical inference depends on whether or not there can be such a thing as fallible knowledge — or whether, once fallibility is present, knowledge departs. Section 9 will consider that issue.

7. Philosophical Sources of Fallibilism: Descartes

Does Hume’s reasoning (described in section 6) support fallibilism in its most general form? It does, if all beliefs depend for their justification upon extrapolations from observational experience. And section 6 also indicated briefly how there can be more beliefs like that than we might realize. Nevertheless, the usual philosophical reading of Hume’s argument does not assume that the argument shows that all beliefs are to be supported either fallibly or not at all. We should therefore pay attention to another equally famous philosophical argument, one whose conclusion is definitely that no beliefs at all are conclusively justified.

This argument comes to us from the seventeenth-century French philosopher René Descartes. In his seminal Meditations on First Philosophy (1911 [1641]), Descartes ended Meditation I skeptically, denying himself all knowledge. How was that skeptical conclusion derived? It was based upon a fallibilism — a wholly general fallibilism. And his argument for that fallibilism — the Evil Genius (or Evil Demon) argument, as it is often called — may be presented in this way:

Any beliefs you have about … well, anything … could be present within you merely because some evil genius or demon has installed them there. And they might have been installed so as to deceive you: maybe any or all of them are false. Admittedly, you do not feel as if this has happened within you. Nonetheless, it could have done so. Note that the evil genius is not simply some other person, even an especially clever one. Rather, it would be God-like in pertinent powers although malevolent in accompanying intent — mysteriously able to implant any false beliefs within you so that their presence will feel natural to you, leaving you unaware that any of your beliefs are bedeviled by this untoward causal origin. You will never notice the evil genius’s machinations. All will seem normal to you within your mind. It will feel just as it would if you were observing and thinking carefully and insightfully.

Is that state of affairs possible? Indeed it is (said Descartes, and most epistemologists have since agreed with him about that). Moreover, if it is always present as a possibility, then one pressing part of it — your being mistaken — is always present as a possibility. This is always present, as a possibility afflicting each of your beliefs. What is true of you in this respect, too, is true of everyone. The evil genius could be manipulating all of our minds. Hence, any belief could be false, no matter who has it and no matter how much evidence they have on its behalf. Even the evidence, after all, could have been installed and controlled by an evil genius.

Interestingly, the reference to an evil genius as such, provocative though it is, was not essential even to Descartes’ own reasoning. In Meditation I, he had already — immediately prior to outlining the Evil Genius argument — presented a sufficiently fallibilist worry. It concerned the possibility of his having been formed or created in some way — whatever way that might be — which would leave him perpetually fallible. He wanted to believe that God was his creator. However (he wondered), would God create him as a being who constantly makes mistakes, or who is at least always liable to do so? God would be powerful enough to do this. But (Descartes also thought) surely God would have had no reason to allow him to make even some mistakes. Yet manifestly Descartes does make them. So (he inferred), he could not take for granted at this early stage of his inquiry (as it is portrayed in his Meditations) that he has actually been formed or created by a perfect God. The evidence of his fallibility opens the door to the possibility that he does not have that causal background. So (he continues), maybe his causal origins are something less than perfect, as of course they would be if anything less than a perfect God were involved in them. In that event, however, he is even more likely to make mistakes than he would be if God was his creator. In one way or the other, therefore (concludes Descartes), fallibility is unavoidable for him: no belief of his is immune from the possibility of being mistaken. Thus, fallibilism is thrust upon Descartes by this reasoning. (He realizes, nonetheless, that it is subtle reasoning. He might not retain it in his thinking. He might overlook his fallibility, if he is not mentally vigilant. Hence, he proceeds to describe the evil genius possibility to himself, as a graphic way of holding the fallibilism fast in his mind. The Evil Genius argument is, in effect, a philosophical mnemonic for him.)

Descartes himself did not remain a fallibilist. He believed that (in his Meditation II) he had found a convincing answer to that fallibilist argument. This answer was his Cogito, one of philosophy’s emblematic moments, and it arose via the following reasoning. Descartes thought that if ever in fact he is being deceived by an evil genius, at least he will thereby be in existence at these moments. (It is impossible to be an object of deception without existing.) The deception would be inflicted upon him while he exists as a thinker — specifically, as someone thinking whatever false thoughts are being controlled within him by the evil genius. But this entails (reasoned Descartes) that there is a kind of thought about which he cannot be deceived, even by an evil genius. Because he can know that he is having a particular thought, he can know that he exists at that time. And so he thought, “I think, therefore I am.” (This is the usual translation into English of the “Cogito, ergo sum” from Latin. The latter version is from Descartes’ Discourse on Method.) He would thereby know that much, at any rate (inferred Descartes). He need not — and at this point in his inquiry he does not think that he can — know which, if any, of his beliefs about the wider world are true. Nonetheless, he has knowledge of his inner world — knowledge of his own thinking. He would know not only that he is thinking, but even what it is that he is thinking. These beliefs about his mental life are conclusively supported, too, because — as he has just argued — they are beyond the relevant reach of any evil genius. No evil genius can give him these thoughts (that he is thinking and hence existing) and thereby be deceiving him.

But most subsequent epistemologists have been more swayed by the fallibilism emerging from the Evil Genius argument than by Descartes’ reply to that argument. (For a discussion of these issues in Descartes’ project, see Curley 1978; Wilson 1978.) One common epistemological objection to his use of the Cogito is as follows. How could Descartes have known that it was he in particular who was thinking? Shouldn’t he have rested content with the more cautious and therefore less dubitable thought, “There is some thinking occurring” — instead of inferring the less cautious and therefore more dubitable thought, “I am thinking”? That objection was proposed by Georg Lichtenberg in the eighteenth century. (For a criticism of it, see Williams 1978: ch. 3.) An advocate of it might call upon such reasoning as this:

In order to know that it is his own thinking, as against just some thinking or other, Descartes has to know already — on independent grounds — that he exists. However, in that event he would not know of his existing, only through his knowing of the thinking actually occurring: he would have some other source of knowledge of his existence. Yet his Cogito had been relied upon by him because he was assuming that his knowing of the thinking actually occurring was (in the face of the imagined evil genius) the only way for him to know of his existence.

That reasoning would claim to give us the following results. (1) Descartes does not know that he is thinking — because he would have to know already that he exists (in order to be the subject of the thinking which is noticed), and because he can know that he exists only if he already knows that he is thinking (the latter knowledge being all that is claimed to be invulnerable to the Evil Genius argument). (2) Similarly, Descartes does not know that he exists — because he would have to know already that he is thinking (this being all that is claimed to be invulnerable to the evil genius argument), and because he could know that he is thinking only by already knowing that he exists (thereby being able to be the subject of the thinking that is being noticed). (3) And once we combine those two results, (1) and (2), what do we find? The objection’s conclusion is that Descartes knows of his thinking and of his existence all at once — or not at all. In short, he is not entitled — as a knower — to the “therefore” in his “I think, therefore I exist.”

That is one possible objection to the Cogito. Still, even if it succeeds on its own terms, it leaves open the following question. Can Descartes have all of that knowledge — the knowledge of his thinking and the knowledge of his existence — all at once? This depends on whether, once he has doubted as strongly and widely as he has done, he can have knowledge even of what is in his own mind. In the mid-twentieth century, the Austrian philosopher Ludwig Wittgenstein mounted a deep challenge to anything like the Cogito as a way of grounding our thought and knowledge. Was Descartes legitimately using words at all so as to form clearly known thoughts, such as “I am thinking”? How could he know what these even mean, unless he is applying some understood language? And Wittgenstein argued that no one could genuinely be thinking thoughts which are not depending upon an immersion in a “public” language, presumably a language shared by other speakers, certainly one already built up over time. In which case, Descartes would be mistaken in believing that, even if the possibility of an evil genius imperils all of his other knowledge, he could retain the knowledge of his own thinking. For even that thinking would have its content only by using terms borrowed from a public language. Hence, Descartes would have to be presupposing some knowledge of that public world, even when supposedly retreating to the inner comfort and security of knowing just what he is thinking. (It should be noted that Wittgenstein himself did not generally direct his reasoning — his Private Language argument, as it came to be called — specifically against Descartes by name. For Wittgenstein’s reasoning, see his 1978 [1953] secs. 243-315, 348-412.)

Of course, even if the Cogito does in fact succeed, epistemologists all-but-unite in denying that such conclusiveness would be available for many — or perhaps any — other beliefs. Accordingly, we would still confront an all-but-universal fallibilism, with Descartes having provided an easy way to remember our all-but-inescapable fallibility. In any case, it remains possible that the Cogito does not succeed, and that instead the evil genius argument shows that no belief is ever conclusively justified. Descartes’ argument is not the only one for such a fallibilism. But most epistemologists still refer to it routinely and with some respect, as being a paradigm argument for the most general form of fallibilism.

8. Implications of Fallibilism: No Knowledge?

If we were to accept that fallibilism is true, to what else would we thereby be committed? In particular, what further philosophical views must we hold (all else being equal) if we hold fallibilism?

Probably the most significant idea that arises, in response to that question, is the suggestion that any fallibilist about justification has to be a skeptic about the existence of knowledge. (There is also the proposal that she must be a skeptic about the existence of justification. Section 10 will discuss that proposal.) This potential implication has made fallibilism particularly interesting to many philosophers. Should we accept the skeptical thesis that because (as fallibilists claim) no one is ever holding a belief infallibly, no one ever has a belief which amounts to being knowledge? In this section and the next, we will consider that question — first (in this section) by examining how one might argue for the skeptical thesis, next (in section 9) by seeing how one might argue against it.

That hypothesized skeptic is reasoning along these lines:

1. Any belief, if it is to be knowledge, needs to be conclusively justified.
2. No belief is conclusively justified. [Fallibilism tells us this.]
3. Hence, no belief is knowledge. [This follows from 1-plus-2.]

Fallibilism gives us 2; deductive logic gives us 3 (as following from 1 and 2); and in this section we are not asking whether fallibilism is true. (We are assuming – for the sake of argument – that it is.) So, our immediate challenge is to ask whether 1 is true. Is it a correct thesis about knowledge? Does knowledge require infallibility (as 1 claims it does)? The rest of this section will evaluate what are probably the two most commonly encountered arguments for the claim that knowledge is indeed like that.

(1) Impossibility. Many people say this about knowledge:

If you have knowledge of some aspect of the world, it is impossible for you to be mistaken about that aspect. (An example: “If you know that it’s a dog, you can’t be mistaken about its being one.”)

We may call that the Impossibility of Mistake thesis. Its advocates might infer, from the conjunction of it with fallibilism, that no one ever has any knowledge. Their reasoning would be like this:

Because no one ever has conclusive justification for a belief, mistakes are always possible within one’s beliefs. Hence, no beliefs attain the rank of knowledge. (We would just think — mistakenly — that often knowledge is present.)

But almost all epistemologists would regard that sort of inference as reflecting a misunderstanding of what the Impossibility of Mistake thesis is actually saying. More specifically, they will say that there is a misunderstanding of how the term “impossible” is being used in that thesis. Here are two possible claims that the Impossibility of Mistake thesis could be thought to be making:

Any instance of knowledge is — indeed, it must be — directed at what is true.  (Knowledge entails truth.)

Any instance of knowledge has as its content what, in itself, could not possibly be false. (Knowledge entails necessary truth.)

The first of those two interpretations of the Impossibility of Mistake thesis says that knowledge, in itself, has to be knowledge of what is true. The second of the two possible interpretations says that knowledge is of what, in itself, has to be true. The two claims will be correlatively different in what they imply.

Epistemologists will insist that the first possible interpretation (which could be called the Necessarily, Knowledge Is of What Is True thesis) is manifestly true — but that it does not join together with fallibilism to entail skepticism. Recall (from (2) in section 2) that fallibilism does not deny that there can be truths among our claims and thoughts. It denies only that we are ever conclusively justified in any specific claim or thought as to which claims or thoughts are true. So, while the Necessarily, Knowledge Is of What Is True thesis entails that any case of knowledge would be knowledge of a truth, fallibilism — because it does not deny that there are truths — does not entail that there is no knowledge.

Epistemologists will also deny that the second possible interpretation (which may be called the Knowledge Is of What Is Necessarily True thesis), even if it is true, entails skepticism. Recall (this time from (3) in section 2) that fallibilism is not a thesis which denies that knowledge could ever be of contingent truths. So, while the Knowledge Is of What Is Necessarily True thesis entails that any case of knowledge would be knowledge of a necessary truth, fallibilism — because it does not, in itself, deny that there is knowledge of contingent truths — does not entail that there is no knowledge. (But most epistemologists, incidentally, will deny that the Knowledge Is of What Is Necessarily True thesis is true. They believe that — if there can be knowledge at all — there can be knowledge of contingent truths, not only of necessary ones.)

(2) Linguistic oddity. Another way in which people are sometimes led to deny that a wholly general fallibilism is compatible with people ever having knowledge is by their reflecting on some supposed linguistic infelicities. Imagine saying or thinking something like this:

“I know that’s true, even though I could be mistaken about its being true.” (An example: “I know that it’s raining, even though I could be mistaken in thinking that it is.”)

That is indeed an odd way to speak or think. Let us refer to it as The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim. Epistemologists also refer to such claims as concessive knowledge-attributions — for short, as CKAs. Should we infer, from that claim’s being so linguistically odd, that no instance of knowledge can allow the possibility (corresponding to the “could” in The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim) of being mistaken? Would this imply the incompatibility of fallibilism with anyone’s ever having knowledge? Does this show that, whenever one’s evidence in support of a belief does not provide a conclusive proof, the belief fails to be knowledge?

Few epistemologists will think so. They are yet to agree on what, exactly, the oddity of a sentence like The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim reflects. (Very roughly: there is some oddity in that claim’s expressed mixture of confidence and caution.) But few of them believe that the oddity — however, ultimately, it is to be understood — will imply that knowledge cannot ever be fallible. Their usual view is that the oddity will be found to reside only in the talking or the thinking — in someone’s actively using — any such sentence. And this could be so (they continue) without the sentence’s also actually being false, even when it is being used. Some sentences which clearly are internally logically consistent — and hence which in some sense could be true — cannot be used without a similar linguistic oddity being manifested. Try saying, for example, “It’s raining, but I don’t believe that it is.” As the twentieth-century English philosopher G. E. Moore remarked (and his observation has come to be called Moore’s Paradox), something is amiss in any utterance of that kind of sentence. (For more on Moore’s Paradox, see Sorensen 1988, ch. 1; Baldwin 1990: 226-32.) This particular sentence — “It’s raining, but I don’t believe that it is” — is manifestly odd, seemingly in a similar way to any utterance of The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim. Yet this does not entail the sentence’s being false. For each half of it could well be true; and they could be true together. The fact that it is raining is logically consistent with the speaker’s not believing that it is. (She could be quite unaware of the weather at the time.) So, the sentence could be true within itself, no matter that it cannot sensibly be uttered, say. That is, its content — what it reports — could be true, even if it cannot sensibly be asserted — as a case of reporting — in living-and-breathing speech or thought.

And the same is true (epistemologists will generally concur) of The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim, the analogous sentence about knowledge and the possibility of being mistaken. Are they correct about that? The next section engages with that question.

9. Implications of Fallibilism: Knowing Fallibly?

The question with which section 8 ended amounts to this: is it possible for there to be fallible knowledge? If The Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim could ever be true, this would be because at least some beliefs are capable of being knowledge even when there is an accompanying possibility of their being mistaken. Any such belief, it seems, would thereby be both knowledge and fallible.

Many epistemologists, probably the majority, wish to accept that there can be fallible knowledge (although they do not always call it this). Few of them are skeptics about knowledge: almost all epistemologists believe that everyone has much knowledge. But what do they believe about the nature of such knowledge? When an epistemologist attributes knowledge, what — more fully — is being attributed? In general, epistemologists also accept that (for reasons such as those outlined in sections 5 through 7) knowledge is rarely, if ever, based upon infallible justification: they believe that there is little, if any, infallible justification. Hence, most epistemologists, it seems, accept that when people do gain knowledge, this usually, maybe always, involves fallibility.

Epistemologists generally regard this fallibilist approach as more likely to generate a realistic conception of knowledge, too. Their aim is to be tolerant of the cognitive fallibilities that people have as inquirers, while nevertheless according people knowledge (usually a great deal of it). The knowledge would therefore be gained in spite of the fallibility. And, significantly, it would be a kind of knowledge which somehow reflects and incorporates the fallibility. Indeed, it would thereby be fallible knowledge. (It would not be infallible knowledge coexisting with fallibility existing only elsewhere in people’s thinking.) With this strategy in mind, then, epistemologists who are fallibilists tend not to embrace skepticism.

Nor (if section 8 is right) should they do so. That section reported (i) the two reasons most commonly thought to show that fallibility in one’s support for a belief is not good enough if the belief is to be knowledge, along with (ii) the explanations of why (according to most epistemologists) those reasons mentioned in (i) are not good enough to entail their intended result. Given (ii), therefore, (i) will at least fail to give us infallible justification for thinking that fallible knowledge is not possible. Accordingly, perhaps such knowledge is possible. But if it is, then what form would it take?

Almost all epistemologists will adopt this generic conception of it:

Any instance of fallible knowledge is a true belief which is at least fallibly (and less than infallibly) justified.

(And remember that F*, in section 4, gave us some sense of what fallible justification is.) Let us call this the Fallible Knowledge Thesis. It is an application, to fallible knowledge in particular, of what is commonly called the Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge. (For an overview of that sort of analysis, see Hetherington 1996.) As stated, the Fallible Knowledge Thesis is quite general, in that it says almost nothing about what specific forms the justification within knowledge might take; all that it does require is that the justification would provide only fallible support.

Nonetheless, generic though it is, the question still arises of whether the Fallible Knowledge Thesis is ever satisfiable, let alone actually satisfied. And that question readily leads into this more specific one: Can a true belief ever be knowledge without having its truth entailed by the justification which is contributing to making the belief knowledge? (Sometimes this talk of justification is replaced by references to warrant, where this designates the justification and/or anything else that is being said to be needed if a particular true belief is to be knowledge. For that use of the term “warrant,” see Plantinga 1993.) Section 8 has disposed of some objections to there being any fallible knowledge; and the previous paragraph has gestured at how — via the Justified-True-Belief Analysis — one might conceive of fallible knowledge. Nonetheless, there could be residual resistance to accepting that there can be fallible knowledge like that. Undoubtedly, some people will think, “There just seems to be something wrong with allowing a belief or claim to be knowledge when it could be mistaken.”

That residual resistance is not clearly decisive, though. It could well owe its existence to a failure to distinguish between two significantly different kinds of question. The first asks whether a particular belief, given the justification supporting it, is true (and thereby fallible knowledge). The other question asks whether, given that belief’s being true, there is enough supporting justification in order for it to be (fallible) knowledge. The former question is raised from “within” a particular inquiry into the truth of a particular belief. The latter question arises from “outside” that inquiry into that belief’s being true (even if this question is arising within another inquiry, perhaps an epistemological one). There is no epistemologically standard way of designating the relevant difference between those kinds of question. Perhaps the following is a helpful way to clarify that difference.

(1) The not-necessarily-epistemological question as to whether a belief is true. Imagine trying to ascertain whether some actual or potential belief or claim is true. You ask yourself, say, “Do I know whether I passed that exam?” Suppose that you have good — fallibly good — evidence in favor of your having passed the exam. (You studied well. You concentrated hard. You felt confident. Your earlier marks in similar exams have been good.) And now suppose that you recall the Justified-True-Belief Analysis. You apply it to your case. What does it tell you? It tells you just that if your actual or possible belief (namely, the belief that you passed the exam) is true, then — given your having fallibly good evidence supporting the belief — the belief is or would be knowledge, albeit fallible knowledge. But does this reasoning tell you whether the belief is knowledge? It does not. All that you have been given is this conditional result: If your belief is true, then (given the justification you have in support of it) the belief is also knowledge. You have no means other than your justification, though, of determining whether the belief is true; and because the justification is fallible, it gives you no guarantee of the belief’s being true (and thereby of being knowledge). Moreover, if fallibilism is true, then any justification which you might have, no matter how extensive or detailed it is, would not save you from that plight. Thus (given fallibilism), you are trapped in the situation of being able to reach, at best, the following conclusion: “Because my evidence provides fallible justification for my belief, the belief is fallible knowledge if it is true.” At which point, most probably, you will wonder, “Is it true? That’s what I still don’t know. (I have no other way of knowing it to be true.)” And so — right there and then — you are denying that your belief is knowledge, because you are denying that you know it to be true. The fallibility in your justification leaves you dissatisfied, as an inquirer into the truth of a particular belief, at the idea of allowing that it could be knowledge, even fallible knowledge. When still inquiring into the truth of a particular belief, it is natural for you to deny that (even if, as it happens, the belief is true) your having fallible justification is enough to make the belief knowledge.

(2) The epistemological question as to whether a belief is knowledge. But the epistemologist’s question (asked at the start of this section) as to whether there can be fallible knowledge is not asked from the sort of inquirer’s perspective described in (1). The epistemologist is not asking whether your particular belief is true (while noting the justification you have for the belief). That is the question you are restricted to asking, when you are proceeding as the inquirer in (1). The epistemological question is subtly different. It does not imagine a fallibly justified belief — before asking, without making any actual or hypothetical commitment as to the belief’s truth, whether the belief is knowledge. Rather, the epistemologist’s question considers the conceptual combination of the belief plus the justification for it plus the belief’s being true — which is to say, the whole package that, in this case, is deemed by the Justified-True-Belief Analysis to be knowledge — before proceeding to ask whether this entirety is an instance of knowledge. To put that observation more simply, this epistemological question asks whether a belief which is fallibly justified, and which is true, is (fallible) knowledge. This is the question of whether your belief is knowledge, given (even if only for argument’s sake) that it is true. In (1), your focus was different to that. In wondering whether you had passed the exam, you were asking whether the belief is true: you were still leaving open the issue of whether or not the belief is true. And, as you realized, your fallible justification was also leaving open that question. For it left open the possibility of the belief’s falsity.

Consequently, from (1), it is obvious why an inquirer might want infallibility in her justification for a belief’s truth. Infallibility would mean her not having to leave open the question of the belief’s truth. Without infallibility, the possibility is left open by her justification (which is her only indication of whether her belief is true) of her belief being false — and hence not knowledge. (This is so, even if we demand that, in order for an inquirer’s belief to be knowledge, she has to know that it is. That demand is called the KK-thesis (with its most influential analysis and defense coming from Hintikka 1962: ch. 5) — because one’s having a piece of knowledge is taken to require one’s Knowing that one has that Knowledge. Yet even satisfying that demand does not remove the rational doubt described in (1). If the extra knowledge — the knowledge of the initial belief’s being knowledge — is not required to be infallible itself, then scope for doubt will remain as to whether the initial belief really is knowledge.) But if we can either (i) know or (ii) suppose (for the sake of another kind of inquiry) that the belief is true, then we may switch our perspective, so as to be asking a different question. That is what the epistemologist is doing in (2), by adopting the latter, (ii), of these two options. She supposes, for the sake of argument, that the belief is true; then she can ask, “Would the belief’s being both true and fallibly justified suffice for it to be knowledge?” She can do this without knowing at all, let alone infallibly, whether the belief is true. (She will also not know infallibly, at least not via this questioning, whether the belief is knowledge. Yet what else is to be expected if fallibilism is true?)

It is also obvious, from (1), why an inquirer might want infallibility in her justification, insofar as she is wondering whether to say or claim that some actual or potential belief of hers is knowledge. Nonetheless, this does not entail her needing such justification if her belief is to be knowledge. Remember — from (2) in section 8 — that whether one has a specific piece of knowledge could be quite a different matter to whether one may properly claim to have it. Similarly, most epistemologists will advise us not to confuse what makes a belief knowledge with what rationally assures someone that her belief is knowledge. For example, it is possible — according to fallibilist epistemologists in general — for a person to have some fallible knowledge, even if she does not know infallibly which of her beliefs attain that status.

This section began by asking the epistemological question of whether there can be fallible knowledge. And with our having seen — in this section’s (2) — what that question is actually asking, along with — in this section’s (1) — what it is not asking, we should end the section by acknowledging that, in asking that epistemological question, we need not be crediting epistemological observers with having a special insight into whether, in general, people’s beliefs are true. The question of whether those beliefs are true is not the question being posed by the epistemological observer. She is asking whether a particular belief is knowledge, given (even if only for argument’s sake) that it is true and fallibly justified. She is asking this from “above” or “outside” the various “lower level” or “inner” attempts to know whether the given beliefs are true. The other (“lower level”) inquirers, in contrast, are asking whether their fallibly justified beliefs are true. There is fallibility in each of those processes of questioning; they just happen to have somewhat different subject-matters and methods.

We should not leave a discussion of the Fallible Knowledge Thesis without observing that, even if it is correct in its general thrust, epistemologists have faced severe challenges in their attempts to complete its details — to make it more precise and less generic. Over the past forty or so years, there have been many such attempts. But these have encountered one problem after another, mostly as epistemologists have struggled to solve what is often called the Gettier Problem, stemming from a 1963 article by Edmund Gettier.

A very brief word on that problem is in order here. It has become the epistemological challenge of defining knowledge precisely, so as to understand all actual or possible cases of knowledge — where one of the project’s guiding assumptions has been that it is possible for instances of knowledge to involve justification which supplies only fallible support. In other words, the project has striven to find a precise analysis of what the Fallible Knowledge Thesis would deem to be fallible knowledge; and, unfortunately, the Gettier Problem is generally thought by epistemologists still to be awaiting a definitive solution. Such a solution would determine wholly and exactly how fallible a particular justified true belief can be, and in what specific ways it can be fallible, without that justified true belief failing to be knowledge. In the meantime (while awaiting that sort of solution), epistemologists incline towards accepting the Justified-True-Belief Analysis — represented here in the Fallible Knowledge Thesis — as being at least approximately correct. Certainly in practice, most epistemologists treat the analysis as being correct enough — so that it functions well as giving us a concept of knowledge that is adequate to whatever demands we would place upon a concept of knowledge within most of the contexts where we need a concept of knowledge at all. Such epistemologists take the difficulties that have been encountered in the attempts to ascertain exactly how a fallibly justified true belief can manage to be knowledge as being difficulties of mere (and maybe less important) detail, not ones of insuperable and vital principle. Those epistemologists tend to assume that eventually the needed details will emerge, that these will be agreed upon by epistemologists, and hence that the basic idea behind the Fallible Knowledge Thesis will finally and definitively be vindicated. (For more on the history of that epistemological project, see Shope 1983 and Hetherington 2016.)

But again, that definitive vindication is yet to be achieved. And, of course, it will not eventuate if we should be answering “No” to the question (discussed earlier in this section) of whether a true belief which is less than infallibly justified is able to be knowledge. When there is fallibility in the justification for a particular true belief, is this fact already sufficient to prevent that belief from being knowledge? Few epistemologists wish to believe so. What we have found in this section is that they are at least not obviously mistaken in that optimistic interpretation.

10. Implications of Fallibilism: No Justification?

Sometimes epistemologists believe that fallibilism opens the door upon an even more striking worry than the one discussed in section 9 (namely, the possibility of there being no knowledge, due to the impossibility of knowledge’s ever being fallible). Sometimes they infer, from the presence of fallibility, that even justification (let alone knowledge) is absent. That is, once fallibility enters, even justification — all justification — departs. Consequently, those epistemologists — once they accept that a universal fallibilism obtains — are skeptics even about the existence of justification. (For an example of such an approach, see Miller 1994: ch. 3.)

How would that interpretation of the impact of fallibilism be articulated? In effect, the idea is that if evidence, say, is to provide even good (let alone very good or excellent or perfect) guidance as to which beliefs are true, it is not allowed to be fallible. No justification worthy of the name is able to be merely fallible. And from that viewpoint, of course, skepticism beckons insofar as no one is ever capable of having any infallible justification. If fallibility is rampant, yet infallibility is required if evidence or the like is ever to be supplying real justification, then no real justification is ever supplied. In short, no beliefs are ever justified.

That is a wholly general skepticism about justification, emerging from a wholly general fallibilism. A possible example of that form of skepticism would be the one with which Descartes ended his Meditation I. Cartesian evil genius skepticism would say that, because there is always the possibility of Descartes’ evil genius (in section 7) controlling our minds, any evidence or reasoning that one ever has could be a result just of the evil genius’s hidden intrusion into one’s mind. The evil genius — by making everything within one’s mind false and misleading — could render false all of one’s evidence, along with all of one’s ideas as to what is good reasoning. None of one’s evidence, and none of one’s beliefs as to how to use that evidence, would be true. However, if there were no truth anywhere in one’s thinking (with one never realizing this), then no components of one’s thinking would be truth-indicative or truth-conducive. No part of one’s thinking would ever lead one to have an accurate belief. Continually, one would both begin and end with falsity. And there are many epistemologists in whose estimation this would mean that no part of one’s thinking is ever really justifying some other part of one’s thinking. For justification is usually supposed to have some relevant link to truth. And presumably there would be no such link, if every single element in one’s thinking is misleading — as would be the case if an evil genius was at work. Is that possible, then? Moreover, is it so dramatic a possibility that if we are forever unable to prove that it is absent, then our minds will never contain real justification for even some of our beliefs?

A potentially less general skepticism about justification would be a Humean inductive skepticism (mentioned in section 6). The thinking behind this sort of skepticism infers — from the inherent fallibility of any inductive extrapolations that could be made from some observations — that no such extrapolation is ever even somewhat rational or justifying. Again, the skeptical interpretation of Humean inductive fallibilism is that, given that all possible extrapolations from observations are fallible, neither logic nor any other form of reason can favor one particular extrapolation over another. The fallibilism implies that there is fallibility within any extrapolation: none are immune. And the would-be skeptic infers from this that, once there is such widespread fallibility, there may as well be a complete absence of any pretence at rationality. The fallibility will be inescapable, even as we seek to defend the rationality of one extrapolation over another. Why is that? Well, we could mount such a defense only by pointing to one sort of extrapolation’s possessing a better past record of predictive success, say. But we would be pointing to that better past record, only in order to infer that such an extrapolation is more trustworthy on the present occasion. And that inference would itself be an inductive extrapolation. It, too, is therefore fallible. Accordingly, if there was previously a need to overcome inductive fallibility (with this need being the reason for consulting the past records of success in the first place), then there remains such a need, even after past records of success have been consulted. In this way, it is the fallibility’s inescapability that generates the skepticism.

Yet, as we noted earlier, most epistemologists would wish to evade or undermine skeptical arguments such as those ones — arguments that seek to convert a kind of fallibilism into a corresponding skepticism. How might this non-skeptical maneuver be achieved? There has been a plethora of attempts, too many to mention here. (For one survey, see Rescher 1980.) Moreover, no consensus has developed on how to escape skeptical arguments like these. That issue is beyond the scope of this article.

What may usefully (even if generically) be described here, however, is a fundamental choice as to how to interpret the force of fallibilism within our cognitive lives. Any response to the skeptical challenges will make that choice (even if usually implicitly and in some more specific way). The basic choice will be between the following two underlying pictures of what a wholly general fallibilism would tell us about ourselves:

(A) The inescapable fallibility of one’s cognitive efforts would be like the inescapable limits — whatever, precisely, these are — upon one’s bodily muscles. These limit what one’s body is capable of — while nonetheless being part of how it achieves whatever it does achieve. Inescapable fallibility would thus be like a background limitation — always present, sometimes a source of frustration, but rarely a danger. When used appropriately, muscles strengthen themselves in accomplished yet limited ways. Would the constant presence of fallibility be like a (fallibly) self-correcting mechanism?

(B) Inescapable fallibility would be like a debilitating illness which “feeds upon” itself. It would become ever more dangerous, as its impact is compounded by repeated use. This would badly lower the quality of one’s thinking. (For a model of that process, notice how easily instances of minor fallibility can interact so as to lead to major fallibility. For example, a sequence in which one slightly fallible piece of evidence after another is used as support for the next can end up providing very weak — overly fallible — support: [80%-probabilification X 80%-probabilification X 80%-probabilification X 80%-probabilification]

How are we to choose between (A) and (B) — between the Limited Muscles model of fallibilism and the Debilitating Illness model of it?

Because most epistemologists are non-skeptics, they favor (A) — the Limited Muscles model. This is not to insist that thinking in an (A)-influenced way is bound to succeed against skeptical arguments. The point right now is simply that this way of thinking is one possible goal for an epistemologist. It is the goal of finding some means of successfully understanding and defending an instance of the Limited Muscles model. What is described by that model would be such a theorist’s desired way to conceive, if this is possible, of the general idea of inescapable fallibility. She will seek to conceive of inescapable fallibility as being manageable, even useful. Hence, the Limited Muscles model is a framework which — in extremely general terms — she will hope allows her to understand — in more specific terms — the nature and significance of fallibilism. Perhaps the most influential modern example of this approach was Quine’s (1969), centered upon a famous metaphor from Neurath (1959 [1932/33], sec. 201). That metaphor portrays human cognitive efforts as akin to a boat, afloat at sea. The boat has its own sorts of fallibility. It is subject to stresses and cracks. And how worrying is that? Must the boat sink whenever those weaknesses manifest themselves? No, because that is not how boats usually function. In general, repairs can be made. This may occur even while the boat is still at sea. Structurally, it is strong enough to support repairs to itself, even as it continues being used, even while making progress towards its destination. Neurath regarded cognitive progress as being like that — as did Quine, who further developed Neurath’s model. On what Quine called his “naturalized” conception of epistemology (a conception that many subsequent thinkers have sought to make more detailed and to apply more widely), human observation and reason make cognitive progress in spite of their fallibility. They do so, even when discovering their own fallibility — finding their own stresses and cracks. Must they then sink, floundering in futility? No. They continue being used, often while repairing their own stresses and cracks — reliably correcting their own deliverances and predictions. Section 5 asked whether science is an especially fallible method. As was also noted, though, science provides impressive results. Indeed, it was Quine’s favored example of large-scale cognitive progress. How can that occur? How can scientific claims — including so many striking ones — be justified, in spite of the fallibility that remains? Maybe science is like a ship that carries within it some skilled and imaginative artisans (carpenters, welders, electricians, and the like). Not only can it survive; it can become more grand and capable when being repaired at sea. (Even so, is such cognitive progress best described in probabilistic terms? On that possibility, implied by Humean fallibilism, see Howson 2000.)

Naturally, in contrast to that optimistic model for thinking about fallible justification, skeptics will prefer (B) — the Debilitating Illness model. We have examined (in sections 6 and 7) a couple of specific ways in which they might try to instantiate that general model. We have also seen (in sections 8 through 10) some reasons why those skeptics might not be right. Perhaps they overstate the force of fallibilism — inferring too much from the facts of fallibility. In any case, the present point is that skeptics (like non-skeptics) seek specific arguments in pursuit of a successful articulation and defense of an underlying picture of inescapable fallibility. Both skeptics and non-skeptics thereby search for an understanding of fallibilism’s nature and significance. They simply reach for opposed conceptions of what fallibilism implies about people’s ability to observe and to reason justifiably.

So, there is a substantial choice to be made; and each of us makes it, more or less carefully and consciously, when reflecting upon these topics. Which of those two basic interpretive directions, then, should we follow? The intellectual implications of this difficult choice are exhilaratingly deep.

11. References and Further Reading

• Baldwin, T. G. E. Moore. London: Routledge, 1990. 226-32.
  • On Moore’s paradox.
• Buckle, S. Hume’s Enlightenment Tract: The Unity and Purpose of An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001. Part 2, chapter 4.
  • On Hume’s famous skeptical reasoning in his first Enquiry.
• Conee, E. and Feldman, R. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2004.
  • A traditional (and popular) approach to understanding the nature of epistemic justification.
• Curley, E. M. Descartes against the Skeptics. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1978.
  • On Descartes’ skeptical doubting.
• Descartes, R. The Philosophical Works of Descartes, Vol. I, (eds. and trans.) E. S. Haldane and G. R. T. Ross. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1911 [1641].
  • Contains both the Discourse and the Meditations. These include both the Evil Genius argument and the Cogito.
• Feldman, R. “Fallibilism and Knowing That One Knows.” The Philosophical Review 90 (1981): 266-82.
  • On the nature and availability of fallible knowledge.
• Gettier, E. L. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23 (1963): 121-3.
  • The genesis of the Gettier Problem.
• Goldman, A. I. “What is Justified Belief?” In G. S. Pappas (ed.), Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1979.
  • An influential analysis of the nature of epistemic justification.
• Hetherington, S. Knowledge Puzzles: An Introduction to Epistemology. Boulder, Colo.: Westview Press, 1996.
  • Includes an overview of many of the commonly noticed difficulties posed by the Gettier problem for our attaining a full understanding of fallible knowledge.
• Hetherington, S. “Knowing Failably.” Journal of Philosophy 96 (1999): 565-87.
  • Describes the genus of which fallible knowledge is a species.
• Hetherington, S. “Fallibilism and Knowing That One Is Not Dreaming.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 32 (2002): 83-102.
  • Shows how fallibilism need not lead to skepticism about knowledge.
• Hetherington, S. “Concessive Knowledge-Attributions: Fallibilism and Gradualism.” Synthese 190 (2013): 2835-51.
  • A fallibilist interpretation of concessive knowledge-attributions (instances of the Self-Doubting Knowledge Claim).
• Hetherington, S. Knowledge and the Gettier Problem. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press (2016).
  • A critical analysis of the history of the Gettier Problem.
• Hintikka, J. Knowledge and Belief: An Introduction to the Logic of the Two Notions Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1962. ch. 5.
  • On the KK-thesis — that is, on knowing that one knows.
• Howson, C. Hume’s Problem: Induction and the Justification of Belief. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
  • A technically detailed response to Hume’s fallibilist challenge to the possibility of inductively justified belief.
• Hume, D. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, in Hume’s Enquiries, (ed.) L. A. Selby-Bigge, 2nd edn. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1902 [1748].
  • This includes, in section IV, the most generally cited version of Hume’s inductive fallibilism and inductive skepticism.
• Kahneman, D., Slovic, P., and Tversky, A. (eds.). Judgment under Uncertainty: Heuristics and Biases. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
  • On empirical evidence of people’s cognitive fallibilities.
• Merricks, T. “More on Warrant’s Entailing Truth.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 57 (1997): 627-31.
  • Argues against the possibility of there being fallible knowledge.
• Miller, D. Critical Rationalism: A Restatement and Defence. Chicago: Open Court, 1994.
  • Discusses many ideas (including a skepticism about epistemic justification) that might arise if fallibilism is true.
• Morton, A. A Guide through the Theory of Knowledge, 3rd edn. Malden, Mass.: Blackwell, 2003. ch. 5.
  • On the basic idea, plus some possible forms, of fallibilism.
• Nagel, T. The View from Nowhere. New York: Oxford University Press, 1986.
  • See especially chapters I and V. Discusses the interplay of different perspectives (“inner” and “outer” ones) that a person might seek upon herself, especially as greater objectivity is sought. (This bears upon section 9’s distinction between two possible kinds of question that can be asked about whether a particular belief is fallible knowledge.)
• Neurath, O. “Protocol Sentences,” in A. J. Ayer (ed.), Logical Positivism. Glencoe, Ill.: The Free Press, 1959 [1932/33].
  • Includes the famous “boat at sea” metaphor.
• Nisbett, R. and Ross, L. Human Inference: Strategies and Shortcomings of Social Judgment. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall, 1980.
  • On empirical evidence of people’s cognitive fallibilities.
• Peirce, C. S. Collected Papers, (eds.) C. Hartshorne and P. Weiss. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1931-60.
  • See, for example, 1.120, and 1.141 through 1.175, for some of Peirce’s originating articulation of the concept of fallibilism as such.
• Plantinga, A. Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press, 1993.
  • An analysis of some proposals as to what warrant might be within (fallible) knowledge.
• Quine, W. V. “Epistemology Naturalized,” in Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press, 1969.
  • A bold and prominent statement of the program of naturalized epistemology, trying to understand fallibility as a part of, rather than a threat to, the justified uses of observation and reason.
• Reed, B. “How to Think about Fallibilism.” Philosophical Studies 107 (2002): 143-57.
  • An attempt to define fallible knowledge.
• Rescher, N. Scepticism: A Critical Reappraisal. Oxford: Blackwell, 1980.
  • On fallibilism and many associated skeptical issues about knowledge and justification.
• Shope, R. K. The Analysis of Knowing: A Decade of Research Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1983.
  • Presents much of the earlier history of attempts to solve the Gettier problem — and thereby to define fallible knowledge.
• Sorensen, R. A. Blindspots. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1988. ch. 1.
  • A philosophical analysis of the kinds of thought or sentence that constitute Moore’s paradox.
• Stove, D. C. Probability and Hume’s Inductive Scepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1973.
  • Explains how Hume’s inductive fallibilism gives way to his inductive skepticism.
• Williams, B. Descartes: The Project of Pure Enquiry. Hassocks: The Harvester Press, 1978.
  • Analysis of Descartes’ skeptical doubts.
• Wilson, M. D. Descartes. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1978.
  • Includes an account of Descartes’ skeptical endeavors.
• Wittgenstein, L. Philosophical Investigations, (trans.) G. E. M. Anscombe. Oxford: Blackwell, 1978 [1953]. Sections 243-315, 348-412.
  • Presents the private language argument (against the possibility of anyone’s being able to think in a language which only they could understand).

Author Information

Stephen Hetherington
Email: s.hetherington@unsw.edu.au
University of New South Wales
Australia

Gettier Problems

Gettier problems or cases are named in honor of the American philosopher Edmund Gettier, who discovered them in 1963. They function as challenges to the philosophical tradition of defining knowledge of a proposition as justified true belief in that proposition. The problems are actual or possible situations in which someone has a belief that is both true and well supported by evidence, yet which — according to almost all epistemologists — fails to be knowledge. Gettier’s original article had a dramatic impact, as epistemologists began trying to ascertain afresh what knowledge is, with almost all agreeing that Gettier had refuted the traditional definition of knowledge. They have made many attempts to repair or replace that traditional definition of knowledge, resulting in several new conceptions of knowledge and of justificatory support. In this respect, Gettier sparked a period of pronounced epistemological energy and innovation — all with a single two-and-a-half page article. There is no consensus, however, that any one of the attempts to solve the Gettier challenge has succeeded in fully defining what it is to have knowledge of a truth or fact. So, the force of that challenge continues to be felt in various ways, and to various extents, within epistemology. Sometimes, the challenge is ignored in frustration at the existence of so many possibly failed efforts to solve it. Often, the assumption is made that somehow it can — and will, one of these days — be solved. Usually, it is agreed to show something about knowledge, even if not all epistemologists concur as to exactly what it shows.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. The Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge
3. Gettier’s Original Challenge
4. Some other Gettier Cases
5. The Basic Structure of Gettier Cases
6. The Generality of Gettier Cases
7. Attempted Solutions: Infallibility
8. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Luck
9. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating False Evidence
10. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Defeat
11. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Inappropriate Causality
12. Attempted Dissolutions: Competing Intuitions
13. Attempted Dissolutions: Knowing Luckily
14. Gettier Cases and Analytic Epistemology
15. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Gettier problems or cases arose as a challenge to our understanding of the nature of knowledge. Initially, that challenge appeared in an article by Edmund Gettier, published in 1963. But his article had a striking impact among epistemologists, so much so that hundreds of subsequent articles and sections of books have generalized Gettier’s original idea into a more wide-ranging concept of a Gettier case or problem, where instances of this concept might differ in many ways from Gettier’s own cases. Philosophers swiftly became adept at thinking of variations on Gettier’s own particular cases; and, over the years, this fecundity has been taken to render his challenge even more significant. This is especially so, given that there has been no general agreement on how to solve the challenge posed by Gettier cases as a group — Gettier’s own ones or those that other epistemologists have observed or imagined. (Note that sometimes this general challenge is called the Gettier problem.) What, then, is the nature of knowledge? And can we rigorously define what it is to know? Gettier’s article gave to these questions a precision and urgency that they had formerly lacked. The questions are still being debated — more or less fervently at different times — within post-Gettier epistemology.

2. The Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge

Gettier cases are meant to challenge our understanding of propositional knowledge. This is knowledge which is described by phrases of the form “knowledge that p,” with “p” being replaced by some indicative sentence (such as “Kangaroos have no wings”). It is knowledge of a truth or fact — knowledge of how the world is in whatever respect is being described by a given occurrence of “p”. Usually, when epistemologists talk simply of knowledge they are referring to propositional knowledge. It is a kind of knowledge which we attribute to ourselves routinely and fundamentally.

Hence, it is philosophically important to ask what, more fully, such knowledge is. If we do not fully understand what it is, will we not fully understand ourselves either? That is a possibility, as philosophers have long realized. Those questions are ancient ones; in his own way, Plato asked them.

And, prior to Gettier’s challenge, different epistemologists would routinely have offered in reply some more or less detailed and precise version of the following generic three-part analysis of what it is for a person to have knowledge that p (for any particular “p”):

1. Belief. The person believes that p. This belief might be more or less confident. And it might — but it need not — be manifested in the person’s speech, such as by her saying that p or by her saying that she believes that p. All that is needed, strictly speaking, is for her belief to exist (while possessing at least the two further properties that are about to be listed).
2. Truth. The person’s belief that p needs to be true. If it is incorrect instead, then — no matter what else is good or useful about it — it is not knowledge. It would only be something else, something lesser. Admittedly, even when a belief is mistaken it can feel to the believer as if it is true. But in that circumstance the feeling would be mistaken; and so the belief would not be knowledge, no matter how much it might feel to the believer like knowledge.
3. Justification. The person’s belief that p needs to be well supported, such as by being based upon some good evidence or reasoning, or perhaps some other kind of rational justification. Otherwise, the belief, even if it is true, may as well be a lucky guess. It would be correct without being knowledge. It would only be something else, something lesser.

Supposedly (on standard pre-Gettier epistemology), each of those three conditions needs to be satisfied, if there is to be knowledge; and, equally, if all are satisfied together, the result is an instance of knowledge. In other words, the analysis presents what it regards as being three individually necessary, and jointly sufficient, kinds of condition for having an instance of knowledge that p.

The analysis is generally called the justified-true-belief form of analysis of knowledge (or, for short, JTB). For instance, your knowing that you are a person would be your believing (as you do) that you are one, along with this belief’s being true (as it is) and its resting (as it does) upon much good evidence. That evidence will probably include such matters as your having been told that you are a person, your having reflected upon what it is to be a person, your seeing relevant similarities between yourself and other persons, and so on.

It is important to bear in mind that JTB, as presented here, is a generic analysis. It is intended to describe a general structuring which can absorb or generate comparatively specific analyses that might be suggested, either of all knowledge at once or of particular kinds of knowledge. It provides a basic outline — a form — of a theory. In practice, epistemologists would suggest further details, while respecting that general form. So, even when particular analyses suggested by particular philosophers at first glance seem different to JTB, these analyses can simply be more specific instances or versions of that more general form of theory.

Probably the most common way for this to occur involves the specific analyses incorporating, in turn, further analyses of some or all of belief, truth, and justification. For example, some of the later sections in this article may be interpreted as discussing attempts to understand justification more precisely, along with how it functions as part of knowledge. In general, the goal of such attempts can be that of ascertaining aspects of knowledge’s microstructure, thereby rendering the general theory JTB as precise and full as it needs to be in order genuinely to constitute an understanding of particular instances of knowing and of not knowing. Steps in that direction by various epistemologists have tended to be more detailed and complicated after Gettier’s 1963 challenge than had previously been the case. Roderick Chisholm (1966/1977/1989) was an influential exemplar of the post-1963 tendency; A. J. Ayer (1956) famously exemplified the pre-1963 approach.

3. Gettier’s Original Challenge

Gettier’s article described two possible situations. This section presents his Case I. (It is perhaps the more widely discussed of the two. The second will be mentioned in the next section.) Subsequent sections will use this Case I of Gettier’s as a focal point for analysis.

The case’s protagonist is Smith. He and Jones have applied for a particular job. But Smith has been told by the company president that Jones will win the job. Smith combines that testimony with his observational evidence of there being ten coins in Jones’s pocket. (He had counted them himself — an odd but imaginable circumstance.) And he proceeds to infer that whoever will get the job has ten coins in their pocket. (As the present article proceeds, we will refer to this belief several times more. For convenience, therefore, let us call it belief b.) Notice that Smith is not thereby guessing. On the contrary; his belief b enjoys a reasonable amount of justificatory support. There is the company president’s testimony; there is Smith’s observation of the coins in Jones’s pocket; and there is Smith’s proceeding to infer belief b carefully and sensibly from that other evidence. Belief b is thereby at least fairly well justified — supported by evidence which is good in a reasonably normal way. As it happens, too, belief b is true — although not in the way in which Smith was expecting it to be true. For it is Smith who will get the job, and Smith himself has ten coins in his pocket. These two facts combine to make his belief b true. Nevertheless, neither of those facts is something that, on its own, was known by Smith. Is his belief b therefore not knowledge? In other words, does Smith fail to know that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket? Surely so (thought Gettier).

That is Gettier’s Case I, as it was interpreted by him, and as it has subsequently been regarded by almost all other epistemologists. The immediately pertinent aspects of it are standardly claimed to be as follows. It contains a belief which is true and justified — but which is not knowledge. And if that is an accurate reading of the case, then JTB is false. Case I would show that it is possible for a belief to be true and justified without being knowledge. Case I would have established that the combination of truth, belief, and justification does not entail the presence of knowledge. In that sense, a belief’s being true and justified would not be sufficient for its being knowledge.

But if JTB is false as it stands, with what should it be replaced? (Gettier himself made no suggestions about this.) Its failing to describe a jointly sufficient condition of knowing does not entail that the three conditions it does describe are not individually necessary to knowing. And if each of truth, belief, and justification is needed, then what aspect of knowledge is still missing? What feature of Case I prevents Smith’s belief b from being knowledge? What is the smallest imaginable alteration to the case that would allow belief b to become knowledge? Would we need to add some wholly new kind of element to the situation? Or is JTB false only because it is too general — too unspecific? For instance, are only some kinds of justification both needed and enough, if a true belief is to become knowledge? Must we describe more specifically how justification ever makes a true belief knowledge? Is Smith’s belief b justified in the wrong way, if it is to be knowledge?

4. Some other Gettier Cases

Having posed those questions, though, we should realize that they are merely representative of a more general epistemological line of inquiry. The epistemological challenge is not just to discover the minimal repair that we could make to Gettier’s Case I, say, so that knowledge would then be present. Rather, it is to find a failing — a reason for a lack of knowledge — that is common to all Gettier cases that have been, or could be, thought of (that is, all actual or possible cases relevantly like Gettier’s own ones). Only thus will we be understanding knowledge in general — all instances of knowledge, everyone’s knowledge. And this is our goal when responding to Gettier cases.

Sections 7 through 11 will present some attempted diagnoses of such cases. In order to evaluate them, therefore, it would be advantageous to have some sense of the apparent potential range of the concept of a Gettier case. I will mention four notable cases.

The lucky disjunction (Gettier’s second case: 1963). Again, Smith is the protagonist. This time, he possesses good evidence in favor of the proposition that Jones owns a Ford. Smith also has a friend, Brown. Where is Brown to be found at the moment? Smith does not know. Nonetheless, on the basis of his accepting that Jones owns a Ford, he infers — and accepts — each of these three disjunctive propositions:

• Either Jones owns a Ford, or Brown is in Boston.
• Either Jones owns a Ford, or Brown is in Barcelona.
• Either Jones owns a Ford, or Brown is in Brest-Litovsk.

No insight into Brown’s location guides Smith in any of this reasoning. He realizes that he has good evidence for the first disjunct (regarding Jones) in each of those three disjunctions, and he sees this evidence as thereby supporting each disjunction as a whole. Seemingly, he is right about that. (These are inclusive disjunctions, not exclusive. That is, each can, if need be, accommodate the truth of both of its disjuncts. Each is true if even one — let alone both — of its disjuncts is true.) Moreover, in fact one of the three disjunctions is true (albeit in a way that would surprise Smith if he were to be told of how it is true). The second disjunction is true because, as good luck would have it, Brown is in Barcelona — even though, as bad luck would have it, Jones does not own a Ford. (As it happened, the evidence for his doing so, although good, was misleading.) Accordingly, Smith’s belief that either Jones owns a Ford or Brown is in Barcelona is true. And there is good evidence supporting — justifying — it. But is it knowledge?

The sheep in the field (Chisholm 1966/1977/1989). Imagine that you are standing outside a field. You see, within it, what looks exactly like a sheep. What belief instantly occurs to you? Among the many that could have done so, it happens to be the belief that there is a sheep in the field. And in fact you are right, because there is a sheep behind the hill in the middle of the field. You cannot see that sheep, though, and you have no direct evidence of its existence. Moreover, what you are seeing is a dog, disguised as a sheep. Hence, you have a well justified true belief that there is a sheep in the field. But is that belief knowledge?

The pyromaniac (Skyrms 1967). A pyromaniac reaches eagerly for his box of Sure-Fire matches. He has excellent evidence of the past reliability of such matches, as well as of the present conditions — the clear air and dry matches — being as they should be, if his aim of lighting one of the matches is to be satisfied. He thus has good justification for believing, of the particular match he proceeds to pluck from the box, that it will light. This is what occurs, too: the match does light. However, what the pyromaniac did not realize is that there were impurities in this specific match, and that it would not have lit if not for the sudden (and rare) jolt of Q-radiation it receives exactly when he is striking it. His belief is therefore true and well justified. But is it knowledge?

The fake barns (Goldman 1976). Henry is driving in the countryside, looking at objects in fields. He sees what looks exactly like a barn. Accordingly, he thinks that he is seeing a barn. Now, that is indeed what he is doing. But what he does not realize is that the neighborhood contains many fake barns — mere barn facades that look like real barns when viewed from the road. And if he had been looking at one of them, he would have been deceived into believing that he was seeing a barn. Luckily, he was not doing this. Consequently, his belief is justified and true. But is it knowledge?

In none of those cases (or relevantly similar ones), say almost all epistemologists, is the belief in question knowledge. (Note that some epistemologists do not regard the fake barns case as being a genuine Gettier case. There is a touch of vagueness in the concept of a Gettier case.)

5. The Basic Structure of Gettier Cases

Although the multitude of actual and possible Gettier cases differ in their details, some characteristics unite them. For a start, each Gettier case contains a belief which is true and well justified without — according to epistemologists as a whole — being knowledge. The following two generic features also help to constitute Gettier cases:

1. Fallibility. The justification that is present within each case is fallible. Although it provides good support for the truth of the belief in question, that support is not perfect, strictly speaking. This means that the justification leaves open at least the possibility of the belief’s being false. The justification indicates strongly that the belief is true — without proving conclusively that it is.
2. Luck. What is most distinctive of Gettier cases is the luck they contain. Within any Gettier case, in fact the well-but-fallibly justified belief in question is true. Nevertheless, there is significant luck in how the belief manages to combine being true with being justified. Some abnormal or odd circumstance is present in the case, a circumstance which makes the existence of that justified and true belief quite fortuitous.

Here is how those two features, (1) and (2), are instantiated in Gettier’s Case I. Smith’s evidence for his belief b was good but fallible. This left open the possibility of belief b being mistaken, even given that supporting evidence. As it happened, that possibility was not realized: Smith’s belief b was actually true. Yet this was due to the intervention of some good luck. Belief b could easily have been false; it was made true only by circumstances which were hidden from Smith. That is, belief b was in fact made true by circumstances (namely, Smith’s getting the job and there being ten coins in his pocket) other than those which Smith’s evidence noticed and which his evidence indicated as being a good enough reason for holding b to be true. What Smith thought were the circumstances (concerning Jones) making his belief b true were nothing of the sort. Luckily, though, some facts of which he had no inkling were making his belief true.

Similar remarks pertain to the sheep-in-the-field case. Within it, your sensory evidence is good. You rely on your senses, taking for granted — as one normally would — that the situation is normal. Then, by standard reasoning, you gain a true belief (that there is a sheep in the field) on the basis of that fallible-but-good evidence. Nonetheless, wherever there is fallibility there is a chance of being mistaken — of gaining a belief which is false. And that is exactly what would have occurred in this case (given that you are actually looking at a disguised dog) — if not, luckily, for the presence behind the hill of the hidden real sheep. Only luckily, therefore, is your belief both justified and true. And because of that luck (say epistemologists in general), the belief fails to be knowledge.

6. The Generality of Gettier Cases

JTB says that any actual or possible case of knowledge that p is an actual or possible instance of some kind of well justified true belief that p — and that any actual or possible instance of some kind of well justified true belief that p is an actual or possible instance of knowledge that p. Hence, JTB is false if there is even one actual or possible Gettier situation (in which some justified true belief fails to be knowledge). Accordingly, since 1963 epistemologists have tried — again and again and again — to revise or repair or replace JTB in response to Gettier cases. The main aim has been to modify JTB so as to gain a ‘Gettier-proof’ definition of knowledge.

How extensive would such repairs need to be? After all, even if some justified true beliefs arise within Gettier situations, not all do so. In practise, such situations are rare, with few of our actual justified true beliefs ever being “Gettiered.” Has Gettier therefore shown only that not all justified true beliefs are knowledge? Correlatively, might JTB be almost correct as it is — in the sense of being accurate about almost all actual or possible cases of knowledge?

On the face of it, Gettier cases do indeed show only that not all actual or possible justified true beliefs are knowledge — rather than that a belief’s being justified and true is never enough for its being knowledge. Nevertheless, epistemologists generally report the impact of Gettier cases in the latter way, describing them as showing that being justified and true is never enough to make a belief knowledge. Why do epistemologists interpret the Gettier challenge in that stronger way?

The reason is that they wish — by way of some universally applicable definition or formula or analysis — to understand knowledge in all of its actual or possible instances and manifestations, not only in some of them. Hence, epistemologists strive to understand how to avoid ever being in a Gettier situation (from which knowledge will be absent, regardless of whether such situations are uncommon). But that goal is, equally, the aim of understanding what it is about most situations that constitutes their not being Gettier situations. If we do not know what, exactly, makes a situation a Gettier case and what changes to it would suffice for its no longer being a Gettier case, then we do not know how, exactly, to describe the boundary between Gettier cases and other situations.

We call various situations in which we form beliefs “everyday” or “ordinary,” for example. In particular, therefore, we might wonder whether all “normally” justified true beliefs are still instances of knowledge (even if in Gettier situations the justified true beliefs are not knowledge). Yet even that tempting idea is not as straightforward as we might have assumed. For do we know what it is, exactly, that makes a situation ordinary? Specifically, what are the details of ordinary situations that allow them not to be Gettier situations — and hence that allow them to contain knowledge? To the extent that we do not understand what it takes for a situation not to be a Gettier situation, we do not understand what it takes for a situation to be a normal one (thereby being able to contain knowledge). Understanding Gettier situations would be part of understanding non-Gettier situations — including ordinary situations. Until we adequately understand Gettier situations, we do not adequately understand ordinary situations — because we would not adequately understand the difference between these two kinds of situation.

7. Attempted Solutions: Infallibility

To the extent that we understand what makes something a Gettier case, we understand what would suffice for that situation not to be a Gettier case. Section 5 outlined two key components — fallibility and luck — of Gettier situations. In this section and the next, we will consider whether removing one of those two components — the removal of which will suffice for a situation’s no longer being a Gettier case — would solve Gettier’s epistemological challenge. That is, we will be asking whether we may come to understand the nature of knowledge by recognizing its being incompatible with the presence of at least one of those two components (fallibility and luck).

There is a prima facie case, at any rate, for regarding justificatory fallibility with concern in this setting. So, let us examine the Infallibility Proposal for solving Gettier’s challenge. There have long been philosophers who doubt (independently of encountering Gettier cases) that allowing fallible justification is all that it would take to convert a true belief into knowledge. (“If you know that p, there must have been no possibility of your being mistaken about p,” they might say.) The classic philosophical expression of that sort of doubt was by René Descartes, most famously in his Meditations on First Philosophy (1641). Contemporary epistemologists who have voiced similar doubts include Keith Lehrer (1971) and Peter Unger (1971). In the opinion of epistemologists who embrace the Infallibility Proposal, we can eliminate Gettier cases as challenges to our understanding of knowledge, simply by refusing to allow that one’s having fallible justification for a belief that p could ever adequately satisfy JTB’s justification condition. Stronger justification than that is required within knowledge (they will claim); infallibilist justificatory support is needed. (They might even say that there is no justification present at all, let alone an insufficient amount of it, given the fallibility within the cases.)

Thus, for instance, an infallibilist about knowledge might claim that because (in Case I) Smith’s justification provided only fallible support for his belief b, this justification was always leaving open the possibility of that belief being mistaken — and that this is why the belief is not knowledge. The infallibilist might also say something similar — as follows — about the sheep-in-the-field case. Because you were relying on your fallible senses in the first place, you were bound not to gain knowledge of there being a sheep in the field. (“It could never be real knowledge, given the inherent possibility of error in using one’s senses.”) And the infallibilist will regard the fake-barns case in the same way, claiming that the potential for mistake (that is, the existence of fallibility) was particularly real, due to the existence of the fake barns. And that is why (infers the infallibilist) there is a lack of knowledge within the case — as indeed there would be within any situation where fallible justification is being used.

So, that is the Infallibility Proposal. The standard epistemological objection to it is that it fails to do justice to the reality of our lives, seemingly as knowers of many aspects of the surrounding world. In our apparently “ordinary” situations, moving from one moment to another, we take ourselves to have much knowledge. Yet we rarely, if ever, possess infallible justificatory support for a belief. And we accept this about ourselves, realizing that we are not wholly — conclusively — reliable. We accept that if we are knowers, then, we are at least not infallible knowers. But the Infallibility Proposal — when combined with that acceptance of our general fallibility — would imply that we are not knowers at all. It would thereby ground a skepticism about our ever having knowledge.

Accordingly, most epistemologists would regard the Infallibility Proposal as being a drastic and mistaken reaction to Gettier’s challenge in particular. In response to Gettier, most seek to understand how we do have at least some knowledge — where such knowledge will either always or almost always be presumed to involve some fallibility. The majority of epistemologists still work towards what they hope will be a non-skeptical conception of knowledge; and attaining this outcome could well need to include their solving the Gettier challenge without adopting the Infallibility Proposal.

8. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Luck

The other feature of Gettier cases that was highlighted in section 5 is the lucky way in which such a case’s protagonist has a belief which is both justified and true. Is it this luck that needs to be eliminated if the situation is to become one in which the belief in question is knowledge? In general, must any instance of knowledge include no accidentalness in how its combination of truth, belief, and justification is effected? The Eliminate Luck Proposal claims so.

Almost all epistemologists, when analyzing Gettier cases, reach for some version of this idea, at least in their initial or intuitive explanations of why knowledge is absent from the cases. Unger (1968) is one who has also sought to make this a fuller and more considered part of an explanation for the lack of knowledge. He says that a belief is not knowledge if it is true only courtesy of some relevant accident. That description is meant to allow for some flexibility. Even so, further care will still be needed if the Eliminate Luck Proposal is to provide real insight and understanding. After all, if we seek to eliminate all luck whatsoever from the production of the justified true belief (if knowledge is thereby to be present), then we are again endorsing a version of infallibilism (as described in section 7). If no luck is involved in the justificatory situation, the justification renders the belief’s truth wholly predictable or inescapable; in which case, the belief is being infallibly justified. And this would be a requirement which (as section 7 explained) few epistemologists will find illuminating, certainly not as a response to Gettier cases.

What many epistemologists therefore say, instead, is that the problem within Gettier cases is the presence of too much luck. Some luck is to be allowed; otherwise, we would again have reached for the Infallibility Proposal. But too large a degree of luck is not to be allowed. This is why we often find epistemologists describing Gettier cases as containing too much chance or flukiness for knowledge to be present.

Nevertheless, how helpful is that kind of description by those epistemologists? How much luck is too much? That is a conceptually vital question. Yet there has been no general agreement among epistemologists as to what degree of luck precludes knowledge. There has not even been much attempt to determine that degree. (It is no coincidence, similarly, that epistemologists in general are also yet to determine how strong — if it is allowed to be something short of infallibility — the justificatory support needs to be within any case of knowledge.) A specter of irremediable vagueness thus haunts the Eliminate Luck Proposal.

Perhaps understandably, therefore, the more detailed epistemological analyses of knowledge have focused less on delineating dangerous degrees of luck than on characterizing substantive kinds of luck that are held to drive away knowledge. Are there ways in which Gettier situations are structured, say, which amount to the presence of a kind of luck which precludes the presence of knowledge (even when there is a justified true belief)? Most attempts to solve Gettier’s challenge instantiate this form of thinking. In sections 9 through 11, we will encounter a few of the main suggestions that have been made.

9. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating False Evidence

A lot of epistemologists have been attracted to the idea that the failing within Gettier cases is the person’s including something false in her evidence. This would be a problem for her, because she is relying upon that evidence in her attempt to gain knowledge, and because knowledge is itself always true. To the extent that falsity is guiding the person’s thinking in forming the belief that p, she will be lucky to derive a belief that p which is true. And (as section 8 indicated) there are epistemologists who think that a lucky derivation of a true belief is not a way to know that truth. Let us therefore consider the No False Evidence Proposal.

In Gettier’s Case I, for example, Smith includes in his evidence the false belief that Jones will get the job. If Smith had lacked that evidence (and if nothing else were to change within the case), presumably he would not have inferred belief b. He would probably have had no belief at all as to who would get the job (because he would have had no evidence at all on the matter). If so, he would thereby not have had a justified and true belief b which failed to be knowledge. Should JTB therefore be modified so as to say that no belief is knowledge if the person’s justificatory support for it includes something false? JTB would then tell us that one’s knowing that p is one’s having a justified true belief which is well supported by evidence, none of which is false.

That is the No False Evidence Proposal. But epistemologists have noticed a few possible problems with it.

First, as Richard Feldman (1974) saw, there seem to be some Gettier cases in which no false evidence is used. Imagine that (contrary to Gettier’s own version of Case I) Smith does not believe, falsely, “Jones will get the job.” Imagine instead that he believes, “The company president told me that Jones will get the job.” (He could have continued to form the first belief. But suppose that, as it happens, he does not form it.) This alternative belief would be true. It would also provide belief b with as much justification as the false belief provided. So, if all else is held constant within the case (with belief b still being formed), again Smith has a true belief which is well-although-fallibly justified, yet which might well not be knowledge.

Second, it will be difficult for the No False Evidence Proposal not to imply an unwelcome skepticism. Quite possibly, there is always some false evidence being relied upon, at least implicitly, as we form beliefs. Is there nothing false at all — not even a single falsity — in your thinking, as you move through the world, enlarging your stock of beliefs in various ways (not all of which ways are completely reliable and clearly under your control)? If there is even some falsity among the beliefs you use, but if you do not wholly remove it or if you do not isolate it from the other beliefs you are using, then — on the No False Evidence Proposal — there is a danger of its preventing those other beliefs from ever being knowledge. This is a worry to be taken seriously, if a belief’s being knowledge is to depend upon the total absence of falsity from one’s thinking in support of that belief.

Unsurprisingly, therefore, some epistemologists, such as Lehrer (1965), have proposed a further modification of JTB — a less demanding one. They have suggested that what is needed for knowing that p is an absence only of significant and ineliminable (non-isolable) falsehoods from one’s evidence for p’s being true. Here is what that means. First, false beliefs which you are — but need not have been — using as evidence for p are eliminable from your evidence for p. And, second, false beliefs whose absence would seriously weaken your evidence for p are significant within your evidence for p. Accordingly, the No False Evidence Proposal now becomes the No False Core Evidence Proposal. The latter proposal says that if the only falsehoods in your evidence for p are ones which you could discard, and ones whose absence would not seriously weaken your evidence for p, then (with all else being equal) your justification is adequate for giving you knowledge that p. The accompanying application of that proposal to Gettier cases would claim that because, within each such case, some falsehood plays an important role in the protagonist’s evidence, her justified true belief based on that evidence fails to be knowledge. On the modified proposal, this would be the reason for the lack of that knowledge.

One fundamental problem confronting that proposal is obviously its potential vagueness. To what extent, precisely, need you be able to eliminate the false evidence in question if knowledge that p is to be present? How easy, exactly, must this be for you? And just how weakened, exactly, may your evidence for p become — courtesy of the elimination of false elements within it — before it is too weak to be part of making your belief that p knowledge? Such questions still await answers from epistemologists.

10. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Defeat

Section 9 explored the suggestion that the failing within any Gettier case is a matter of what is included within a given person’s evidence: specifically, some core falsehood is accepted within her evidence. A converse idea has also received epistemological attention — the thought that the failing within any Gettier case is a matter of what is not included in the person’s evidence: specifically, some notable truth or fact is absent from her evidence. This proposal would not simply be that the evidence overlooks at least one fact or truth. Like the unmodified No False Evidence Proposal (with which section 9 began), that would be far too demanding, undoubtedly leading to skepticism. Because there are always some facts or truths not noticed by anyone’s evidence for a particular belief, there would be no knowledge either. No one’s evidence for p would ever be good enough to satisfy the justification requirement that is generally held to be necessary to a belief that p’s being knowledge.

Epistemologists therefore restrict the proposal, turning it into what is often called a defeasibility analysis of knowledge. It can also be termed the No Defeat Proposal. The thought behind it is that JTB should be modified so as to say that what is needed in knowing that p is an absence from the inquirer’s context of any defeaters of her evidence for p. And what is a defeater? A particular fact or truth t defeats a body of justification j (as support for a belief that p) if adding t to j, thereby producing a new body of justification j*, would seriously weaken the justificatory support being provided for that belief that p — so much so that j* does not provide strong enough support to make even the true belief that p knowledge. This means that t is relevant to justifying p (because otherwise adding it to j would produce neither a weakened nor a strengthened j*) as support for p — but damagingly so. In effect, insofar as one wishes to have beliefs which are knowledge, one should only have beliefs which are supported by evidence that is not overlooking any facts or truths which — if left overlooked — function as defeaters of whatever support is being provided by that evidence for those beliefs.

In Case I, for instance, we might think that the reason why Smith’s belief b fails to be knowledge is that his evidence includes no awareness of the facts that he will get the job himself and that his own pocket contains ten coins. Thus, imagine a variation on Gettier’s case, in which Smith’s evidence does include a recognition of these facts about himself. Then either (i) he would have conflicting evidence (by having this evidence supporting his, plus the original evidence supporting Jones’s, being about to get the job), or (ii) he would not have conflicting evidence (if his original evidence about Jones had been discarded, leaving him with only the evidence about himself). But in either of those circumstances Smith would be justified in having belief b — concerning “the person,” whoever it would be, who will get the job. Moreover, in that circumstance he would not obviously be in a Gettier situation — with his belief b still failing to be knowledge. For, on either (i) or (ii), there would be no defeaters of his evidence — no facts which are being overlooked by his evidence, and which would seriously weaken his evidence if he were not overlooking them.

Unfortunately, however, this proposal — like the No False Core Evidence Proposal in section 9 — faces a fundamental problem of vagueness. As we have seen, defeaters defeat by weakening justification: as more and stronger defeaters are being overlooked by a particular body of evidence, that evidence is correlatively weakened. (This is so, even when the defeaters clash directly with one’s belief that p. And it is so, regardless of the believer’s not realizing that the evidence is thereby weakened.) How weak, exactly, can the justification for a belief that p become before it is too weak to sustain the belief’s being knowledge that p? This question — which, in one form or another, arises for all proposals which allow knowledge’s justificatory component to be satisfied by fallible justificatory support — is yet to be answered by epistemologists as a group. In the particular instance of the No Defeat Proposal, it is the question, raised by epistemologists such as William Lycan (1977) and Lehrer and Paxson (1969), of how much — and which aspects — of one’s environment need to be noticed by one’s evidence, if that evidence is to be justification that makes one’s belief that p knowledge. There can be much complexity in one’s environment, with it not always being clear where to draw the line between aspects of the environment which do — and those which do not — need to be noticed by one’s evidence. How strict should we be in what we expect of people in this respect?

11. Attempted Solutions: Eliminating Inappropriate Causality

It has also been suggested that the failing within Gettier situations is one of causality, with the justified true belief being caused — generated, brought about — in too odd or abnormal a way for it to be knowledge. This Appropriate Causality Proposal — initially advocated by Alvin Goldman (1967) — will ask us to consider, by way of contrast, any case of observational knowledge. Seemingly, a necessary part of such knowledge’s being produced is a stable and normal causal pattern’s generating the belief in question. You use your eyes in a standard way, for example. A belief might then form in a standard way, reporting what you observed. That belief will be justified in a standard way, too, partly by that use of your eyes. And it will be true in a standard way, reporting how the world actually is in a specific respect. All of this reflects the causal stability of normal visually-based belief-forming processes. In particular, we realize that the object of the knowledge — that perceived aspect of the world which most immediately makes the belief true — is playing an appropriate role in bringing the belief into existence.

Within Gettier’s Case I, however, that pattern of normality is absent. The aspects of the world which make Smith’s belief b true are the facts of his getting the job and of there being ten coins in his own pocket. But these do not help to cause the existence of belief b. (That belief is caused by Smith’s awareness of other facts — his conversation with the company president and his observation of the contents of Jones’s pocket.) Should JTB be modified accordingly, so as to tell us that a justified true belief is knowledge only if those aspects of the world which make it true are appropriately involved in causing it to exist?

Epistemologists have noticed problems with that Appropriate Causality Proposal, though.

First, some objects of knowledge might be aspects of the world which are unable ever to have causal influences. In knowing that 2 + 2 = 4 (this being a prima facie instance of what epistemologists term a priori knowledge), you know a truth — perhaps a fact — about numbers. And do they have causal effects? Most epistemologists do not believe so. (Maybe instances of numerals, such as marks on paper being interpreted on particular occasions in specific minds, can have causal effects. Yet — it is usually said — such numerals are merely representations of numbers. They are not the actual numbers.) Consequently, it is quite possible that the scope of the Appropriate Causality Proposal is more restricted than is epistemologically desirable. The proposal would apply only to empirical or a posteriori knowledge, knowledge of the observable world — which is to say that it might not apply to all of the knowledge that is actually or possibly available to people. And (as section 6 explained) epistemologists seek to understand all actual or possible knowledge, not just some of it.

Second, to what extent will the Appropriate Causality Proposal help us to understand even empirical knowledge? The problem is that epistemologists have not agreed on any formula for exactly how (if there is to be knowledge that p) the fact that p is to contribute to bringing about the existence of the justified true belief that p. Inevitably (and especially when reasoning is involved), there will be indirectness in the causal process resulting in the formation of the belief that p. But how much indirectness is too much? That is, are there degrees of indirectness that are incompatible with there being knowledge that p? And if so, how are we to specify those critical degrees?

For example, suppose that (in an altered Case I of which we might conceive) Smith’s being about to be offered the job is actually part of the causal explanation of why the company president told him that Jones would get the job. The president, with his mischievous sense of humor, wished to mislead Smith. And suppose that Smith’s having ten coins in his pocket made a jingling noise, subtly putting him in mind of coins in pockets, subsequently leading him to discover how many coins were in Jones’s pocket. Given all of this, the facts which make belief b true (namely, those ones concerning Smith’s getting the job and concerning the presence of the ten coins in his pocket) will actually have been involved in the causal process that brings belief b into existence. Would the Appropriate Causality Proposal thereby be satisfied — so that (in this altered Case I) belief b would now be knowledge? Or should we continue regarding the situation as being a Gettier case, a situation in which (as in the original Case I) the belief b fails to be knowledge? If we say that the situation remains a Gettier case, we need to explain why this new causal ancestry for belief b would still be too inappropriate to allow belief b to be knowledge.

Most epistemologists will regard the altered case as a Gettier case. But in that event they continue to owe us an analysis of what makes a given causal history inappropriate. Often, they talk of deviant causal chains. And that is an evocative phrase. But how clear is it? Once more, we will wonder about vagueness. In particular, we will ask, how deviant can a causal chain (one that results in some belief-formation) become before it is too deviant to be able to be bringing knowledge into existence? As we also found in sections 9 and 10, a conceptually deep problem of vagueness thus remains to be solved.

12. Attempted Dissolutions: Competing Intuitions

Sections 9 through 11 described some of the main proposals that epistemologists have made for solving the Gettier challenge directly. Those proposals accept the usual interpretation of each Gettier case as containing a justified true belief which fails to be knowledge. Each proposal then attempts to modify JTB, the traditional epistemological suggestion for what it is to know that p. What is sought by those proposals, therefore, is an analysis of knowledge which accords with the usual interpretation of Gettier cases. That analysis would be intended to cohere with the claim that knowledge is not present within Gettier cases. And why is it so important to cohere with the latter claim? The standard answer offered by epistemologists points to what they believe is their strong intuition that, within any Gettier case, knowledge is absent. Almost all epistemologists claim to have this intuition about Gettier cases. They treat this intuition with much respect. (It seems that most do so as part of a more general methodology, one which involves the respectful use of intuitions within many areas of philosophy. Frank Jackson [1998] is a prominent proponent of that methodology’s ability to aid our philosophical understanding of key concepts.)

Nonetheless, a few epistemological voices dissent from that approach (as this section and the next will indicate). These seek to dissolve the Gettier challenge. Instead of accepting the standard interpretation of Gettier cases, and instead of trying to find a direct solution to the challenge that the cases are thereby taken to ground, a dissolution of the cases denies that they ground any such challenge in the first place. And one way of developing such a dissolution is to deny or weaken the usual intuition by which almost all epistemologists claim to be guided in interpreting Gettier cases.

One such attempt has involved a few epistemologists — Jonathan Weinberg, Shaun Nichols, and Stephen Stich (2001) — conducting empirical research which (they argue) casts doubt upon the evidential force of the usual epistemological intuition about the cases. When epistemologists claim to have a strong intuition that knowledge is missing from Gettier cases, they take themselves to be representative of people in general (specifically, in how they use the word “knowledge” and its cognates such as “know,” knower,” and the like). That intuition is therefore taken to reflect how “we” — people in general — conceive of knowledge. It is thereby assumed to be an accurate indicator of pertinent details of the concept of knowledge — which is to say, “our” concept of knowledge. Yet what is it that gives epistemologists such confidence in their being representative of how people in general use the word “knowledge”? Mostly, epistemologists test this view of themselves upon their students and upon other epistemologists. The empirical research by Weinberg, Nichols, and Stich asked a wider variety of people — including ones from outside of university or college settings — about Gettier cases. And that research has reported encountering a wider variety of reactions to the cases. When people who lack much, or even any, prior epistemological awareness are presented with descriptions of Gettier cases, will they unhesitatingly say (as epistemologists do) that the justified true beliefs within those cases fail to be knowledge? The empirical evidence gathered so far suggests some intriguing disparities in this regard — including ones that might reflect varying ethnic ancestries or backgrounds. In particular, respondents of east Asian or Indian sub-continental descent were found to be more open than were European Americans (of “Western” descent) to classifying Gettier cases as situations in which knowledge is present. A similar disparity seemed to be correlated with respondents’ socio-economic status.

Those data are preliminary. (And other epistemologists have not sought to replicate those surveys.) Nonetheless, the data are suggestive. At the very least, they constitute some empirical evidence that does not simply accord with epistemologists’ usual interpretation of Gettier cases. Hence, a real possibility has been raised that epistemologists, in how they interpret Gettier cases, are not so accurately representative of people in general. Their shared, supposedly intuitive, interpretation of the cases might be due to something distinctive in how they, as a group, think about knowledge, rather than being merely how people as a whole regard knowledge. In other words, perhaps the apparent intuition about knowledge (as it pertains to Gettier situations) that epistemologists share with each other is not universally shared. Maybe it is at least not shared with as many other people as epistemologists assume is the case. And if so, then the epistemologists’ intuition might not merit the significance they have accorded it when seeking a solution to the Gettier challenge. (Indeed, that challenge itself might not be as distinctively significant as epistemologists have assumed it to be. This possibility arises once we recognize that the prevalence of that usual putative intuition among epistemologists has been important to their deeming, in the first place, that Gettier cases constitute a decisive challenge to our understanding of what it is to know that p.)

Epistemologists might reply that people who think that knowledge is present within Gettier cases are not evaluating the cases properly — that is, as the cases should be interpreted. The question thus emerges of whether epistemologists’ intuitions are particularly trustworthy on this topic. Are they more likely to be accurate (than are other people’s intuitions) in what they say about knowledge — in assessing its presence in, or its absence from, specific situations? Presumably, most epistemologists will think so, claiming that when other people do not concur that in Gettier cases there is a lack of knowledge, those competing reactions reflect a lack of understanding of the cases — a lack of understanding which could well be rectified by sustained epistemological reflection.

Potentially, that disagreement has methodological implications about the nature and point of epistemological inquiry. For we should wonder whether those epistemologists, insofar as their confidence in their interpretation of Gettier cases rests upon their more sustained reflection about such matters, are really giving voice to intuitions as such about Gettier cases when claiming to be doing so. Or are they instead applying some comparatively reflective theories of knowledge? The latter alternative need not make their analyses mistaken, of course. But it would make more likely the possibility that the analyses of knowledge which epistemologists develop in order to understand Gettier cases are not based upon a directly intuitive reading of the cases. This might weaken the strength and independence of the epistemologists’ evidential support for those analyses of knowledge.

For example, maybe the usual epistemological interpretation of Gettier cases is manifesting a commitment to a comparatively technical and demanding concept of knowledge, one that only reflective philosophers would use and understand. Even if the application of that concept feels intuitive to them, this could be due to the kind of technical training that they have experienced. It might not be a coincidence, either, that epistemologists tend to present Gettier cases by asking the audience, “So, is this justified true belief within the case really knowledge?” — thereby suggesting, through this use of emphasis, that there is an increased importance in making the correct assessment of the situation. The audience might well feel a correlative caution about saying that knowledge is present. They could feel obliged to take care not to accord knowledge if there is anything odd — as, clearly, there is — about the situation being discussed. When that kind of caution and care are felt to be required, then — as contextualist philosophers such as David Lewis (1996) have argued is appropriate — we are more likely to deny that knowledge is present.

Hence, if epistemologists continue to insist that the nature of knowledge is such as to satisfy one of their analyses (where this includes knowledge’s being such that it is absent from Gettier cases), then there is a correlative possibility that they are talking about something — knowledge — that is too difficult for many, if any, inquirers ever to attain. How should people — as potential or actual inquirers — react to that possibility? Mark Kaplan (1985) has argued that insofar as knowledge must conform to the demands of Gettier cases (and to the usual epistemological interpretation of them), knowledge is not something about which we should care greatly as inquirers. And the fault would be knowledge’s, not ours. Kaplan advocates our seeking something less demanding and more realistically attainable than knowledge is if it needs to cohere with the usual interpretation of Gettier cases. (An alternative thought which Kaplan’s argument might prompt us to investigate is that of whether knowledge itself could be something less demanding — even while still being at least somewhat worth seeking. Section 13 will discuss that idea.)

Those pivotal issues are currently unresolved. In the meantime, their presence confirms that, by thinking about Gettier cases, we may naturally raise some substantial questions about epistemological methodology — about the methods via which we should be trying to understand knowledge. Those questions include the following ones. What evidence should epistemologists consult as they strive to learn the nature of knowledge? Should they be perusing intuitions? If so, whose? Their own? How should competing intuitions be assessed? And how strongly should favored intuitions be relied upon anyway? Are they to be decisive? Are they at least powerful? Or are they no more than a starting-point for further debate — a provider, not an adjudicator, of relevant ideas?

13. Attempted Dissolutions: Knowing Luckily

Section 12 posed the question of whether supposedly intuitive assessments of Gettier situations support the usual interpretation of the cases as strongly — or even as intuitively — as epistemologists generally believe is the case. How best might that question be answered? Sections 5 and 8 explained that when epistemologists seek to support that usual interpretation in a way that is meant to remain intuitive, they typically begin by pointing to the luck that is present within the cases. That luck is standardly thought to be a powerful — yet still intuitive — reason why the justified true beliefs inside Gettier cases fail to be knowledge.

Nevertheless, a contrary interpretation of the luck’s role has also been proposed, by Stephen Hetherington (1998; 2001). It means to reinstate the sufficiency of JTB, thereby dissolving Gettier’s challenge. That contrary interpretation could be called the Knowing Luckily Proposal. And it analyses Gettier’s Case I along the following lines.

This alternative interpretation concedes (in accord with the usual interpretation) that, in forming his belief b, Smith is lucky to be gaining a belief which is true. More fully: He is lucky to do so, given the evidence by which he is being guided in forming that belief, and given the surrounding facts of his situation. In that sense (we might say), Smith came close to definitely lacking knowledge. (For in that sense he came close to forming a false belief; and a belief which is false is definitely not knowledge.) But to come close to definitely lacking knowledge need not be to lack knowledge. It might merely be to almost lack knowledge. So (as we might also say), it could be to know, albeit luckily so. Smith would have knowledge, in virtue of having a justified true belief. (We would thus continue to regard JTB as being true.) However, because Smith would only luckily have that justified true belief, he would only luckily have that knowledge.

Most epistemologists will object that this sounds like too puzzling a way to talk about knowing. Their reaction is natural. Even this Knowing Luckily Proposal would probably concede that there is very little (if any) knowledge which is lucky in so marked or dramatic a way. And because there is so little (if any) such knowledge, our everyday lives leave us quite unused to thinking of some knowledge as being present within ourselves or others quite so luckily: we would actually encounter little (if any) such knowledge. To the extent that the kind of luck involved in such cases reflects the statistical unlikelihood of such circumstances occurring, therefore, we should expect at least most knowledge not to be present in that lucky way. (Otherwise, this would be the normal way for knowledge to be present. It would not in fact be an unusual way. Hence, strictly speaking, the knowledge would not be present only luckily.)

But even if the Knowing Luckily Proposal agrees that, inevitably, at least most knowledge will be present in comparatively normal ways, the proposal will deny that this entails the impossibility of there ever being at least some knowledge which is present more luckily. Ordinarily, when good evidence for a belief that p accompanies the belief’s being true (as it does in Case I), this combination of good evidence and true belief occurs (unlike in Case I) without any notable luck being needed. Ordinary knowledge is thereby constituted, with that absence of notable luck being part of what makes instances of ordinary knowledge ordinary in our eyes. What is ordinary to us will not strike us as being present only luckily. Again, though, is it therefore impossible for knowledge ever to be constituted luckily? The Knowing Luckily Proposal claims that such knowledge is possible even if uncommon. The proposal will grant that there would be a difference between knowing that p in a comparatively ordinary way and knowing that p in a comparatively lucky way. Knowing comparatively luckily that p would be (i) knowing that p (where this might remain one’s having a justified true belief that p), even while also (ii) running, or having run, a greater risk of not having that knowledge that p. In that sense, it would be to know that p less securely or stably or dependably, more fleetingly or unpredictably.

There are many forms that the lack of stability — the luck involved in the knowledge’s being present — could take. Sometimes it might include the knowledge’s having one of the failings found within Gettier cases. The knowledge — the justified true belief — would be present in a correspondingly lucky way. One interpretive possibility — from Hetherington (2001) — is that of describing this knowledge that p as being of a comparatively poor quality as knowledge that p. Normally, knowledge that p is of a higher quality than this — being less obviously flawed, by being less luckily present. The question persists, though: Must all knowledge that p be, in effect, normal knowledge that p — being of a normal quality as knowledge that p? Or could we sometimes — even if rarely — know that p in a comparatively poor and undesirable way? The Knowing Luckily Proposal allows that this is possible — that this is a conceivable form for some knowledge to take.

That proposal is yet to be widely accepted among epistemologists. Their main objection to it has been what they have felt to be the oddity of talking of knowledge in that way. Accordingly, the epistemological resistance to the proposal partly reflects the standard adherence to the dominant (“intuitive”) interpretation of Gettier cases. Yet this section and the previous one have asked whether epistemologists should be wedded to that interpretation of Gettier cases. So, this section leaves us with the following question: Is it conceptually coherent to regard the justified true beliefs within Gettier cases as instances of knowledge which are luckily produced or present? And how are we to answer that question anyway? With intuitions? Whose? Once again, we encounter section 12’s questions about the proper methodology for making epistemological progress on this issue.

14. Gettier Cases and Analytic Epistemology

Since the initial philosophical description in 1963 of Gettier cases, the project of responding to them (so as to understand what it is to know that p) has often been central to the practice of analytic epistemology. Partly this recurrent centrality has been due to epistemologists’ taking the opportunity to think in detail about the nature of justification — about what justification is like in itself, and about how it is constitutively related to knowledge. But partly, too, that recurrent centrality reflects the way in which, epistemologists have often assumed, responding adequately to Gettier cases requires the use of a paradigm example of a method that has long been central to analytic philosophy. That method involves the considered manipulation and modification of definitional models or theories, in reaction to clear counterexamples to those models or theories.

Thus (we saw in section 2), JTB purported to provide a definitional analysis of what it is to know that p. JTB aimed to describe, at least in general terms, the separable-yet-combinable components of such knowledge. Then Gettier cases emerged, functioning as apparently successful counterexamples to one aspect — the sufficiency — of JTB’s generic analysis. That interpretation of the cases’ impact rested upon epistemologists’ claims to have reflective-yet-intuitive insight into the absence of knowledge from those actual or possible Gettier circumstances. These claims of intuitive insight were treated by epistemologists as decisive data, somewhat akin to favored observations. The claims were to be respected accordingly; and, it was assumed, any modification of the theory encapsulated in JTB would need to be evaluated for how well it accommodated them. So, the entrenchment of the Gettier challenge at the core of analytic epistemology hinged upon epistemologists’ confident assumptions that (i) JTB failed to accommodate the data provided by those intuitions — and that (ii) any analytical modification of JTB would need (and would be able) to be assessed for whether it accommodated such intuitions. That was the analytical method which epistemologists proceeded to apply, vigorously and repeatedly.

Nevertheless, the history of post-1963 analytic epistemology has also contained repeated expressions of frustration at the seemingly insoluble difficulties that have accompanied the many attempts to respond to Gettier’s disarmingly simple paper. Precisely how should the theory JTB be revised, in accord with the relevant data? Exactly which data are relevant anyway? We have seen in the foregoing sections that there is much room for dispute and uncertainty about all of this. For example, we have found a persistent problem of vagueness confronting various attempts to revise JTB. This might have us wondering whether a complete analytical definition of knowledge that p is even possible.

That is especially so, given that vagueness itself is a phenomenon, the proper understanding of which is yet to be agreed upon by philosophers. There is much contemporary discussion of what it even is (see Keefe and Smith 1996). On one suggested interpretation, vagueness is a matter of people in general not knowing where to draw a precise and clearly accurate line between instances of X and instances of non-X (for some supposedly vague phenomenon of being X, such as being bald or being tall). On that interpretation of vagueness, such a dividing line would exist; we would just be ignorant of its location. To many philosophers, that idea sounds regrettably odd when the vague phenomenon in question is baldness, say. (“You claim that there is an exact dividing line, in terms of the number of hairs on a person’s head, between being bald and not being bald? I find that claim extremely hard to believe.”) But should philosophers react with such incredulity when the phenomenon in question is that of knowing, and when the possibility of vagueness is being prompted by discussions of the Gettier problem? For most epistemologists remain convinced that their standard reaction to Gettier cases reflects, in part, the existence of a definite difference between knowing and not knowing. But where, exactly, is that dividing line to be found? As we have observed, the usual epistemological answers to this question seek to locate and to understand the dividing line in terms of degrees and kinds of justification or something similar. Accordingly, the threats of vagueness we have noticed in some earlier sections of this article might be a problem for many epistemologists. Possibly, those forms of vagueness afflict epistemologists’ knowing that a difference between knowledge and non-knowledge is revealed by Gettier cases. Epistemologists continue regarding the cases in that way. Are they right to do so? Do they have that supposed knowledge of what Gettier cases show about knowledge?

The Gettier challenge has therefore become a test case for analytically inclined philosophers. The following questions have become progressively more pressing with each failed attempt to convince epistemologists as a group that, in a given article or talk or book, the correct analysis of knowledge has finally been reached. Will an adequate understanding of knowledge ever emerge from an analytical balancing of various theories of knowledge against relevant data such as intuitions? Must any theory of the nature of knowledge be answerable to intuitions prompted by Gettier cases in particular? And must epistemologists’ intuitions about the cases be supplemented by other people’s intuitions, too? What kind of theory of knowledge is at stake? What general form should the theory take? And what degree of precision should it have? If we are seeking an understanding of knowledge, must this be a logically or conceptually exhaustive understanding? (The methodological model of theory-being-tested-against-data suggests a scientific parallel. Yet need scientific understanding always be logically or conceptually exhaustive if it is to be real understanding?)

The issues involved are complex and subtle. No analysis has received general assent from epistemologists, and the methodological questions remain puzzling. Debate therefore continues. There is uncertainty as to whether Gettier cases — and thereby knowledge — can ever be fully understood. There is also uncertainty as to whether the Gettier challenge can be dissolved. Have we fully understood the challenge itself? What exactly is Gettier’s legacy? As epistemologists continue to ponder these questions, it is not wholly clear where their efforts will lead us. Conceptual possibilities still abound.

15. References and Further Reading

• Ayer, A. J. (1956). The Problem of Knowledge (London: Macmillan), ch. 1.
  • Presents a well-regarded pre-Gettier JTB analysis of knowledge.
• Chisholm, R. M. (1966/1977/1989). Theory of Knowledge (any of the three editions). (Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice Hall).
  • Includes the sheep-in-the-field Gettier case, along with attempts to repair JTB.
• Descartes, R. (1911 [1641]). The Philosophical Works of Descartes, Vol. I, (eds. and trans.) E. S. Haldane and G. R. T. Ross. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
  • Contains the Meditations, which develops and applies Descartes’s conception of knowledge as needing to be infallible.
• Feldman, R. (1974). “An Alleged Defect in Gettier Counterexamples.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 52: 68-9. Reprinted in Moser (1986).
  • Presents a Gettier case in which, it is claimed, no false evidence is used by the believer.
• Gettier, E. L. (1963). “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3. Reprinted in Roth and Galis (1970) and Moser (1986).
• Goldman, A. I. (1967). “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 357-72. Reprinted, with revisions, in Roth and Galis (1970).
  • The initial presentation of a No Inappropriate Causality Proposal.
• Goldman, A. I.. (1976). “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-91. Reprinted in Pappas and Swain (1978).
  • Includes the fake-barns Gettier case.
• Hetherington, S. (1996). Knowledge Puzzles: An Introduction to Epistemology (Boulder, Colo.: Westview Press).
  • Includes an introduction to the justified-true-belief analysis of knowledge, and to several responses to Gettier’s challenge.
• Hetherington, S. (1998). “Actually Knowing.” Philosophical Quarterly 48: 453-69.
  • Includes a version of the Knowing Luckily Proposal.
• Hetherington, S. (2001). Good Knowledge, Bad Knowledge: On Two Dogmas of Epistemology (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
  • Extends the Knowing Luckily Proposal, by explaining the idea of having qualitatively better or worse knowledge that p.
• Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics: A Defence of Conceptual Analysis (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
  • Includes discussion of Gettier cases and the role of intuitions and conceptual analysis.
• Kaplan, M. (1985). “It’s Not What You Know That Counts.” Journal of Philosophy 82: 350-63.
  • Argues that, given Gettier cases, knowledge is not what inquirers should seek.
• Keefe, R. and Smith, P. (eds.) (1996). Vagueness: A Reader (Cambridge, Mass.: The MIT Press).
  • Contains both historical and contemporary analyses of the nature and significance of vagueness in general.
• Kirkham, R. L. (1984). “Does the Gettier Problem Rest on a Mistake?” Mind 93: 501-13.
  • Argues that the usual interpretation of Gettier cases depends upon applying an extremely demanding conception of knowledge to the described situations, a conception with skeptical implications.
• Lehrer, K. (1965). “Knowledge, Truth and Evidence.” Analysis 25: 168-75. Reprinted in Roth and Galis (1970).
  • Presents a No Core False Evidence Proposal.
• Lehrer, K. (1971). “Why Not Scepticism?” The Philosophical Forum 2: 283-98. Reprinted in Pappas and Swain (1978).
  • Outlines a skepticism based on an Infallibility Proposal about knowledge.
• Lehrer, K., and Paxson, T. D. (1969). “Knowledge: Undefeated Justified True Belief.” Journal of Philosophy 66: 225-37. Reprinted in Pappas and Swain (1978).
  • Presents a No Defeat Proposal.
• Lewis, D. (1996). “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-67.
  • Includes a much-discussed response to Gettier cases which pays attention to nuances in how people discuss knowledge.
• Lycan, W. G. (1977). “Evidence One Does not Possess.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 55: 114-26.
  • Discusses potential complications in a No Defeat Proposal.
• Lycan, W. G. (2006). “On the Gettier Problem Problem.” In Epistemology Futures, (ed.) S. Hetherington. (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
  • A recent overview of the history of attempted solutions to the Gettier problem.
• Moser, P. K. (ed.) (1986). Empirical Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology (Totowa, NJ: Rowman & Littlefield).
  • Contains some influential papers on Gettier cases.
• Pappas, G. S., and Swain, M. (eds.) (1978). Essays on Knowledge and Justification (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press).
  • A key anthology, mainly on the Gettier problem.
• Plato. Meno 97a-98b.
  • For what epistemologists generally regard as being an early version of JTB.
• Plato. Theatetus 200d-210c.
  • For seminal philosophical discussion of some possible instances of JTB.
• Roth, M. D., and Galis, L. (eds.) (1970). Knowing: Essays in the Analysis of Knowledge (New York: Random House).
  • Includes some noteworthy papers on Gettier’s challenge.
• Shope, R. K. (1983). The Analysis of Knowing: A Decade of Research (Princeton: Princeton University Press).
  • Presents many Gettier cases; discusses several proposed analyses of them.
• Skyrms, B. (1967). “The Explication of ‘X Knows that p’.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 373-89. Reprinted in Roth and Galis (1970).
  • Includes the pyromaniac Gettier case.
• Unger, P. (1968). “An Analysis of Factual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 65: 157-70. Reprinted in Roth and Galis (1970).
  • Presents an Eliminate Luck Proposal.
• Unger, P. (1971). “A Defense of Skepticism.” The Philosophical Review 30: 198-218. Reprinted in Pappas and Swain (1978).
  • Defends and applies an Infallibility Proposal about knowledge.
• Weinberg, J., Nichols, S., and Stich, S. (2001). “Normativity and Epistemic Intuitions.” Philosophical Topics 29: 429-60.
  • Includes empirical data on competing (‘intuitive’) reactions to Gettier cases.
• Williamson, T. (2000). Knowledge and Its Limits (Oxford: Oxford University Press), Intro., ch. 1.
  • Includes arguments against responding to Gettier cases with an analysis of knowledge.

Author Information

Stephen Hetherington
Email: s.hetherington@unsw.edu.au
University of New South Wales
Australia