Alfred Schutz (1899—1959)

Alfred Schutz philosophized about social science in a broad signification of the word. He was deeply respectful of actual scientific practice, and produced a classification of the sciences; explicated methodological postulates for empirical science in general and the social sciences specifically; and clarified basic concepts for interpretative sociology in particular. His work shows how philosophy of the cultural sciences can be done phenomenologically.

He characterized his approach in terms of what Husserl called “constitutive phenomenology of the natural attitude.” Schutz appears to have considered this sufficient for his science-theoretical purposes, even though he also understood transcendental phenomenology clearly. His objections to positivism aside, there are three main themes to Schutz’s philosophy of the social sciences: defining their region, clarifying their categories, and articulating their postulates.

Life and Works
Phenomenological Philosophy of the Social Sciences
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Alfred Schutz was born in Vienna in 1899. Like Ludwig Wittgenstein and Karl Popper, Edmund Husserl, Sigmund Freud, and Franz Brentano, Schutz came from the last phase of the Austro-Hungarian Empire. He was an only child in an upper-middle-class Austrian Jewish family and had a strong mother. In his youth he attended a classical Gymnasium in Vienna and developed a lifelong interest in music. After his serving in World War I, he received his doctorate in the philosophy of law at Vienna under Hans Kelsen in three years; studied marginal-utility economics; and became interested in the interpretative (verstehende) sociology of Max Weber. His initial attempt to ground the social sciences in the philosophy of Henri Bergson not proving satisfactory, he was led late in the 1920s by his friend Felix Kaufmann to study Edmund Husserl’s Vorlesungen zur Phänomenologie des inneren Zeitbewusstsein (1928) and Formale und transzendentale Logik (1929) and, on that basis, committed himself to phenomenology for the rest of his life.

Schutz completed Der sinnhafte Aufbau der sozialen Welt in 1932. On the recommendation of Tomoo Otaka as well as Kaufmann, he sent a copy to Husserl, who invited him to Freiburg and soon asked him to become his assistant. It was necessary, however, for Schutz to continue his career as a banking executive in order to support his family. Husserl called him an executive by day and a phenomenologist by night. He visited Husserl often until the latter’s death in 1938 and continued to write essays, especially in the philosophy of economics.

After the Nazi Anschluss, he helped many others flee the Nazis; he himself moved first to Paris and then to New York, where he continued to work in a private banking firm. Soon he also began teaching sociology and eventually philosophy in the evenings at the Graduate Faculty of Political and Social Science of the New School for Social Research.

His correspondence with Aron Gurwitsch well documents his thinking from 1939 until 1959, when he died. Schutz published dozens of essays in the United States and began working toward a second book during his last decade. Before his death, however, he was only able to outline an arrangement of passages from various essays, eventually fleshed out by Thomas Luckmann in two volumes. But Schutz had also managed to plan several volumes of Collected Papers that his widow and two other students quickly edited after his death. Moreover, translations of the Aufbau into English as well as it and volumes of papers into a number of Western and Asian languages began in the 1960s. His quite extensive, international, and multidisciplinary influence is still growing within and beyond philosophy. His oeuvre also continues to reward close study. Volume IV of his papers has been published, Volume V Phenomenology and the Social Sciences was published in 2011. A Werkausgabe has appeared in German, and there are Schutz archives at Yale University in the United States, Konstanz University in Germany, and Waseda University in Japan. Several international conferences were held in the centennial year of 1999, and there is a video of his life and work.

2. Phenomenological Philosophy of the Social Sciences

If phenomenology is comprehended in the strict signification now sometimes qualified as Husserlian, there can be no doubt that Alfred Schutz is the preeminent phenomenological philosopher of the social sciences. But such a characterization needs to be comprehended carefully. “Philosophy” in this connection as well as “social science” have somewhat distinctive significations for him.

In his 1932 book Schutz lists not only economics, jurisprudence, sociology, and political science, but also biography and the histories of art, economics, music, philosophy, and politics (and implicitly archaeology) as “Sozialwissenschaften.” This may reflect Austrian views early in the last century, but in his American period he similarly lists cultural anthropology, economics, history, law, linguistics, sociology, and the sciences of mythology and religion. This list can seem odd today because the historical sciences and jurisprudence are not usually considered social sciences, at least in the United States. A broader title seems necessary. In the Austrian writings, “Geisteswissenschaften” is used as an alternative for what can be called “the social sciences in the broad signification,” and this has been rendered as “human sciences” in recent translations. Another expression, “Kulturwissenschaften,” is, however, rather prominent in the original German of “Phenomenology and the Social Sciences” of 1940, the manifesto written at the time of his transition to his new country; it even occurs in the original title. “Cultural science” might be preferred as an alternative to “social science” in the broad signification. Moreover, “Wissenschaft,” usually translated as “science,” is not confined in German thought to explanatory disciplines based on experimentation and sensuous perception. One gets the most from studying Schutz if one bears in mind that his philosophy of the cultural sciences is concerned with all of the above listed disciplines. In Austria, Schutz used forms of “Wissenschaftstheorie,” including “Theorie der Sozialwissenschaften,” to characterize his work; in the United States he initially used “methodology and epistemology” to render “Wissenschaftslehre,” but later preferred “theory of the social sciences.” The expression “philosophy of the social sciences” does not occur in his oeuvre, perhaps because it had not yet been coined in his time.

In Schutz’s theory of science or “science theory,” as it might also be called (although this is not his expression), the concern is emphatically with the basic concepts and postulates of scientific thinking per se. What is particularly interesting about Schutz’s position, is, however, his recognition that the cultural or social scientists regularly reflect on those same themes, that is, that they too engage in science theory. This makes discussions of basic concepts and methodology between scientists and philosophers possible. Schutz was especially impressed by Max Weber’s science theory, he found some science-theoretical reflections in Hans Kelsen’s pure theory of law, and he unsuccessfully sought a discussion of science-theoretical issues with the sociologist Talcott Parsons. He did succeed in having such discussions with some “Austrian school” economists, including Fritz Machlup, Friedrich A. Hayek, and Ludwig von Mises. He recognized, however, that science-theoretical reflections by scientists tend to be limited by the needs of the particular disciplines and hence seldom reach a fully philosophical level. Schutz’s project as a philosopher was then to reflect on the practices of the cultural sciences, asking intelligent questions and learning from the scientists themselves, and then interpreting for them what they do, thereby possibly eliminating some difficulties in the foundations of the edifice of science that they seldom inspect. Schutz’s approach can be called a “gentle prescriptivism,” which may be why his thought has been very well received in a score of non-philosophical disciplines concerned with aspects of the sociocultural world. “Theory of science” can be an inclusionary title, while “philosophy” in this age of hyperspecialization is often exclusionary, with the consequence that efforts by cultural scientists to reflect on their own disciplines are not taken seriously by philosophers. Schutz’s Aufbau is a masterpiece in Wissenschaftslehre regarding interpretative sociology and begins with an examination of the sociologist Max Weber’s science-theoretical reflections on that science. Probably because he taught only sociology in the early years, had prominent students in that discipline (for example, Thomas Luckmann), and had a will to communicate with scientists,

Schutz is sometimes characterized as a “phenomenological sociologist.” But he also taught philosophy, including students such as Maurice Natanson, and nearly all of his publications are clearly philosophical scholarship or investigations. When his New School colleague Leo Strauss once praised him as “a philosophically sophisticated sociologist,” Schutz responded that he preferred to be considered “a sociologically sophisticated philosopher.” Finally, it is crucial to recognize that Schutz’s philosophy of the social sciences is phenomenological. This signifies that he reflectively analyzes how sociocultural objects are constructed with meaning in everyday life, largely with concepts found in ordinary language and thereby open to interpretation. More will be said about this presently, but it deserves mention at this point that he characterized his approach in terms of what Husserl called “constitutive phenomenology of the natural attitude.” Schutz appears to have considered this sufficient for his science-theoretical purposes, even though he also understood transcendental phenomenology clearly.

His objections to positivism aside, there are three main themes to Schutz’s philosophy of the social sciences: defining their region, clarifying their categories, and articulating their postulates. In the first place, there is the problem of the delimitations of the realm of the social sciences in both the broad and the narrow significations. Schutz held that all science is theoretical and requires entry into the preconstituted subuniverse of a discipline. “On Multiple Realities” (1945)—perhaps his most famous essay—is devoted to contrasting the theoretical and practical attitudes, phantasy and dream being considered along the way. In other texts he offers a taxonomy of the positive sciences. Except to agree with Husserl on the unification of all sciences by formal logic, Schutz has little to say about the formal sciences. This and his opposition to positivism may have led some to believe that he opposed mathematization in the cultural sciences, but he clearly accepted it in economics, arguably the most mathematized social science, and could easily have accepted it elsewhere as well.

On the assumption of an implicit distinction between sciences of content and sciences of form, the “contentual sciences,” as they might be called, are, for Schutz, of two kinds, the naturalistic and the cultural. Against much philosophy of science, especially in the Anglo-American world, Schutz agreed with Dilthey and Husserl before him, and later with others such as Gurwitsch, on the priority of the cultural over the naturalistic sciences. This is because when first theorized about, the world is concretely cultural, that is, it is always already interpreted on the common-sense level of everyday life and ordinary language. While one can then immediately engage in cultural science, a further type abstraction is needed in order to distinguish nature from the rest of the cultural world and engage in naturalistic science. The abstraction from the common-sense interpretation by which the subject matter of the naturalistic sciences is constituted can become deeply habitual and traditional in philosophers as well as scientists. But because of this abstraction, the nature obtained hardly “comes naturally” to us, and the sciences in which aspects of it are thematized can be called “naturalistic,” although Schutz did not use this expression. (It may also now be clearer why “cultural science” can be preferred for the sciences that thematize aspects of the original and concrete cultural world.) And Schutz believed, by the way, that there was more to be learned about human knowledge from the cultural than from the naturalistic sciences—behaviorists, for example, being unable to account for how they themselves ca even practice science. As might have been suspected when the broad signification of social or, better, cultural science was introduced above, some specification of this kind of science is called for.

Unfortunately, Schutz does not discuss psychology as a cultural science, but he does distinguish the social sciences in what can be called the narrow signification from the historical sciences. His position is that the world of others has three basic regions, that of “contemporaries,” who are alive at the same time with a given member or group, the scientist included, that of “predecessors,” who are dead; and that of “successors,” who are yet to be born. Predecessors can influence contemporaries by writing wills, for example, and successors can similarly be influenced by contemporaries (and predecessors). Successors cannot be understood, however, since there is nothing yet to understand, and predecessors can be understood through texts, traces, and oral tradition. Only for contemporaries is mutual influencing and understanding possible. “Consociates” make up a subset of contemporaries who can reciprocally as well as unilaterally understand and influence one another within a shared place as well as in the shared time of all contemporaries. The social sciences in the narrow signification are then about contemporaries and the historical sciences are about predecessors.

But the rise of “contemporary history” has made this division problematical. Since Schutz accepted the universes of the sciences as they are defined by the scientific communities concerned, it is likely that he would have accepted that contemporary history is history, although it is not clear how he might have corrected his original position on the difference of the historical from the social sciences in the narrow signification. Perhaps the historical sciences are different because they extend their explanations beyond the realm of contemporaries into that of predecessors, while social sciences confine their explanations to the realm of contemporaries, but Schutz does not state or imply this.

The second theme of Schutz’s theory of the cultural sciences is the clarification of the categories or “basic concepts” of the sciences. To show what this is about, it is most efficient merely to quote the list on the first page of Schutz’s Aufbau of the basic concepts of interpretative sociolology that he then attempts to clarify in his book: “the interpretation of one’s own and others’ experiences, meaning-establishment and meaning-interpretation, symbol and symptom, motive and project, meaning-adequacy and causal adequacy, and, above all, the nature of ideal-typical concept formation.” Investigation beyond Schutz’s work should pursue similar concepts in other disciplines, beginning from the science-theoretical reflections of the scientists themselves while always being prepared to go further.

The third theme of Schutz’s philosophy or theory of the social or cultural sciences is methodology in a narrow signification. It is about rules of procedure, which are articulated with “postulates.” These are to be obtained by reflective observation and analysis of actual scientific practice, then reported back to the scientists whose practice they explicate. A complete interpretation of Schutz’s thought in this respect has yet to be published. Besides those postulates included in the several lists, the moves, for example, of abstracting nature from the rest of the sociocultural world in the naturalistic sciences and of using individual action as a starting point in the cultural sciences are explicitly said to be postulates, while the requirement of adopting a theoretical attitude is only implicitly a postulate for all science.

Schutz recognized that there were many more postulates yet to be explicated from scientific practice. But five can be mentioned here, three for the empirical sciences in general and two for specifically social or cultural science. In all empirical sciences, naturalistic as well as cultural, (1) all terms are to be as clear and distinct as possible; (2) propositions are to be consistent and compatible within and between particular disciplines; and (3) all scientific thought is to be derived directly or indirectly from tested observation. (In the naturalistic sciences this observation is sensuous, but in the cultural sciences it is chiefly interpretation of statements by informants.) In the cultural sciences specifically,

(4) there is the postulate of subjective meaning or interpretation, which Schutz has from Max Weber. By this postulate, models of aspects of the sociocultural world, which are scientific constructs about common-sense constructs, must ultimately refer to the subjective meaning of the actor on the social scene. The actor alone knows her purpose, where her action begins and ends, what its stages are, and afterward how well she has succeeded. When a surgeon decides not to operate, that too is an action. The partner in an interaction is next most cognizant of but still not privy to what can also be called the “insider interpretation” of the action by the actor. Then come the other “outsider interpretation,” so to speak, those of the observer in everyday life, followed by that of the cultural scientist, and finally that of the science theorist, who is thus at four removes from the originally meaningful action.

(5) By the postulate of adequacy, the account produced by the cultural scientist must be understandable by the actor or group reflected on. This recourse to the informant(s) after the fact of scientific interpretation is similar to Schutz’s philosophical recourse to the science-theoretical analyses produced by the cultural scientists themselves, just as the attitude of the scientist is similar to that of the observer in everyday life.

There are subsidiary components to Schutz’s theory of the cultural sciences, such as the recognition of schools of thought within disciplines, but the foregoing should suffice to prepare the reader to study his oeuvre. But something can also be said about areas in which his thinking has been and/or needs to be extended. In the first place, while there is considerable focus on the particular sciences of economics and sociology, the scope of Schutz’s science theory is clearly much broader. If this is recognized, then it is also clear that philosophers inspired by his work could engage in discussions with scientists of other disciplines (for example, archaeologists), seeking to define the discipline, to clarify its basic concepts, and to explicate postulates for them. In the second place, while Schutz is emphatic that the constructs produced in the cultural sciences are constructs of a second level that are about the constructs of the first level, which is that of common sense and ordinary language, he did not ask what the constructs of the primary level are themselves about. This is undoubtedly because in everyday life a conceptualization of objects automatically occurs that is perhaps most obvious in how names come to mind (or awkwardly fail to do so) when one encounters objects. In addition, the words “meaning” and “significance” can shed more shadow than light. If one abstracts from such conceptualization, however, one can observe that cultural objects already have values and uses that are not conceptual meanings bestowed on sheerly physical things, but original determinations of the objects that such conceptual meanings are bestowed upon and that ordinary language refers to. Consequently, two abstractions are actually needed to reach the nature thematized in the naturalistic sciences. This is not to reject Schutz’s interpretationism, but it is to assert that cultural objects, situations, and worlds are cultural by virtue of values and uses that are not reducible to conceptual meaning-bestowal and categorial formation. In the third place,

Schutz’s great emphasis is on theoretical science, but there are also the so-called “applied sciences,” such as nursing and psychiatry, which are deserving of great attention from philosophers, and one can explore how Schutz’s science theory can be extended to include such disciplines. These practical disciplines are perhaps better characterized as “science-based” rather than “applied” because rarely is only one science applied in them; instead, the practitioners select what suits their purposes from various theoretical disciplines and unhesitatingly engage in theoretical research themselves where it is needed. Finally, a comparative study of Schutz’s theory of the cultural sciences, which does emphasize the social sciences in the narrow signification, with the theory of the interpretation and critique of texts and traces—that is, hermeneutics, which can be said to emphasize the historical sciences—should shed light on both and perhaps lead toward a more balanced and complete theory of the cultural sciences in general.

Overall, Alfred Schutz’s work is a model for the philosophical analysis of science that begins from reflective observation on scientific practices as relating to the objects of their provinces and, correlatively, on such objects as theorized about and observed in those practices.

3. References and Further Reading

Alfred Schutz Aron Gurwitsch Briefwechsel 1939-1959. Ed. Richard Grathoff. Munich: Wilhelm Fink, 1985. English translation: Philosophers in Exile: The Correspondence of Alfred Schutz and Aron Gurwitsch, 1939-1959. Trans. J. Claude Evans. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1989.
“Choice and the Social Sciences.” Ed. Lester E. Embree. In Life-World and Consciousness: Essays for Aron Gurwitsch. Ed. Lester E. Embree, Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1972, 565-90.
“Husserl and His Influence on Me.” Ed. Lester Embree. The Annals of Phenomenological Sociology 2 (1977), 40-44.
Collected Papers, Vol. I, The Problem of Social Reality. Ed. Maurice Natanson. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1962.
Collected Papers, Vol. II, Studies in Social Theory, Ed. Arvid Brodersen, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1964.
Collected Papers, Vol. III, Studies in Phenomenological Philosophy. Ed. Ilse Schutz. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1966.
Collected Papers, Vol. IV. Ed. Helmut Wagner, George Psathas, and Fred Kersten, Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1996.
“Positivistic Philosophy and the Actual Approach of Interpretative Social Science: An Ineditum of Alfred Schutz from Spring 1953.” Ed. Lester Embree. Husserl Studies 14 (1997), 123-49.
Reflections on the Problem of Relevance. Ed. Richard M. Zaner. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1970.
Der sinnhafte Aufbau der sozialen Welt [1932]. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Taschenbuch, 1974. English translation: Phenomenology of the Social World. Trans. George Walsh and Frederick Lehnert. Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1967.
The Theory of Social Action. Ed. Richard Grathoff. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1978.
Alfred Schutz and Thomas Luckmann, Die Strukturen der Lebenswelt, 2 vols. Neuwied: Luchterhand, 1975; Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1953. English translation: The Structures of the Lifeworld, Vol. I. Trans. Richard M. Zaner and H. Tristram Engelhardt, Jr.; Vol. II. Trans. Richard M. Zaner and David J. Parent. Evanston, Ill: Northwestern University Press, 1973, 1989.

Author Information

Lester Embree
Email: embree@fau.edu
Florida Atlantic University
U. S. A.

The Epistemology of Perception

EpisPerc Perception is a central issue in epistemology, the theory of knowledge. At root, all our empirical knowledge is grounded in how we see, hear, touch, smell and taste the world around us. In section 1, a distinction is drawn between perception that involves concepts and perception that doesn’t, and the various epistemic relations that there are between these two types of perception are discussed–our perceptual beliefs and our perceptual knowledge. Section 2 considers the role of causation in perception and focuses on the question of whether perceptual experience justifies our beliefs or merely causes them. Sections 3 and 4 further investigate the epistemic role of perception and introduce two distinct conceptions of the architecture of our belief system: foundationalism and coherentism. It is shown how perceptual experience and perceptual beliefs are integrated into these systems. Finally, section 5 turns to the externalist view that thinkers need not be aware of what justifies their perceptual beliefs.

Perception and Belief
1. Seeing That, Seeing As and Simple Seeing
2. Perceptual Beliefs
Perception, Justification and Causation
1. Armstrong’s Causal Account of Perceptual Knowledge
Perception and Foundationalism
Perception and Coherentism
1. The Basic Idea Behind Coherentism
2. Bonjour and the Spontaneous Nature of Perceptual Beliefs
Externalism
References and Further Reading

1. Perception and Belief

a. Seeing That, Seeing As and Simple Seeing

Perception is the process by which we acquire information about the world around us using our five senses. Consider the nature of this information. Looking out of your window, you see that it is raining. Your perception represents the world as being like that. To perceive the world in this way, therefore, it is required that you possess concepts, that is, ways of representing and thinking about the world. In this case, you require the concept RAIN. Thus, seeing that your coffee cup is yellow and that the pencil is green involves the possession of the concepts COFFEE CUP, YELLOW, PENCIL and GREEN. Such perception is termed “perceiving that,” and is factive; that is, it is presupposed that you perceive the world correctly. To perceive that it is raining, it must be true that it is raining. You can also, though, perceive the world to be a certain way and yet be mistaken. This we can call, “perceiving as,” or in the usual case, “seeing as”. A stick partly submerged in water may not be bent but, nevertheless, you see it as bent. Your perception represents the stick as being a certain way, although it turns out that you are wrong. Much of your perception, then, is representational: you take the world to be a certain way, sometimes correctly, when you see that the world is thus and so, and sometimes incorrectly, when the world is not how you perceive it to be.

It also seems that there is a form of perception that does not require the possession of concepts (although this claim has been questioned). It is plausible to claim that cognitively unsophisticated creatures, those that are not seen as engaging in conceptually structured thought, can perceive the world, and that at times we can perceptually engage with the world in a non-conceptual way. You can tell that the wasp senses or perceives your presence because of its irascible behavior. When you are walking along the High Street daydreaming, you see bus stops, waste bins, and your fellow pedestrians. You must see them because you do not bump into them, but you do not see that the bus stop is blue or that a certain pedestrian is wearing Wrangler jeans. You can, of course, come to see the street in this way if you focus on the scene in front of you, but the claim here is that there is a coherent form of perception that does not involve such conceptual structuring. Let us call such baseline perceptual engagement with the world, “simple seeing”. This perception involves the acquisition of perceptual information about the world, information that enables us to visually discriminate objects and to successfully engage with them, but also information that does not amount to one having a conceptually structured representation of the world. (Dretske, 1969, refers to simple seeing as “non-epistemic” seeing, and refers to ‘seeing that’ as “epistemic” seeing).

You can, then, simply see the bus stop, or you can see that the bus stop is blue, or you can, mistakenly, see the bus stop as made of sapphire. These are all forms of perceptual experience, ways you have of causally engaging with the world using your sensory apparatus and ways that have a distinctive conscious or “phenomenological” dimension. Seeing in its various forms strikes your consciousness in a certain way, a way that you are now experiencing as you look at your computer screen. This article investigates the causal and epistemic roles of this perceptual experience.

A little more terminology: the term “sensation” can be used to refer to the conscious aspect of perception, but note that one can have such sensations even when one would not be said to be perceiving the world. When hallucinating, for example, one is having the sensations usually characteristic of perceptual experience, even though in such cases one’s experience would not be described as perceptual.

Consider how these various kinds of perceptual experience are related to our perceptual beliefs. Perceptual beliefs are those concerning the perceptible features of our environment, and they are beliefs that are grounded in our perceptual experience of the world. The content of such beliefs can be acquired in other ways: You could be told that the bus stop is blue, or you could remember that it is blue. Right now, though, waiting for the bus, you acquire this belief by looking straight at it, and, thus, you have a perceptual belief concerning this particular fact. Just how your perceptual beliefs are grounded in your perceptual experience is a contentious issue. There is certainly a causal relation between the two, but some philosophers also claim that it is perceptual experience that provides justification for our perceptual beliefs. This foundationalist claim is denied by the coherentist (see sections 3 and 4 below).

b. Perceptual Beliefs

First, one does not necessarily come to acquire perceptual beliefs in virtue of simply seeing the world. Simple seeing is something that cognitively unsophisticated creatures can do, creatures such as wasps that do not have more sophisticated beliefs, propositional beliefs. It is plausible, though, that if one sees a certain object as a bus stop, then one would also come to believe that there is a bus stop being seen. In many cases, this is, of course, true, but it is not in all. A famous example is the Muller-Lyer illusion:

muller-lyer

The two horizontal lines above look as though they are of different lengths, the upper line being longer than the lower. If we have seen the illusion before, then we do not believe our eyes. Instead, we believe that the lines are the same length (which they are). Here is another case: a habitual user of hallucinogenics may doubt the veracity of all his perceptions; he may not believe anything he sees. His perception, however, amounts to more than simply seeing; he sees the moon as being made of cheese and his cup of tea as grinning up at him. Yet, because of the doubt fostered by his frequent hallucinations, he does not move from seeing the world as being a certain way to believing that it is. In most cases, though, if one sees the world as being a certain way, then one also believes that it is that way. Last, let us return to the notion of “perceiving that.” Such perception has a closer relationship with the acquisition of perceptual belief. If one is described as perceiving that the world is a certain way, it is implied that one also believes that the world is so. Here, there isn’t room for perception to come apart from belief.

Thus, we have seen that we can be perceptually engaged with the world in various ways. Such engagement can amount to the mere acquisition of perceptual information, the experience of seeing the world as being a certain way, or the possession of the cognitive states of perceiving and believing that it is so. If all goes well, such perceptual beliefs may constitute perceptual knowledge of the world. According to the traditional account, this is when those beliefs are true and when they are justified. Perceptual knowledge consists in knowledge of the perceptible features of the world around us, and it is that which is grounded in our perceptual experience. Again, the nature of this grounding is controversial. Perceptual experience is certainly causally related to perceptual knowledge; foundationalists, however, make the further claim that such experience provides the justification that is constitutive of such knowledge (see section 3). Others, though, including Armstrong (section 2a) and the coherentists (section 4), do not believe perceptual experience plays this justificatory role with respect to perceptual knowledge. The next section considers this key issue of justification.

But consider the issue of skepticism. The skeptical arguments of Descartes (1641) have had an enormous influence on both the history and practice of epistemology. He suggests certain scenarios that threaten to undermine all of our empirical knowledge of the world. It could be that right now you are dreaming. If you were, everything might appear to you just as it currently does; dreams are sometimes very real. It is also possible that a powerful demon might be deliberately deceiving you; there may not be an external world at all, and all your perceptual experience and perceptual beliefs may be simply planted in your mind by this evil entity. Given such scenarios, it is not clear how our perceptual beliefs can be justified and thus, how we can have perceptual knowledge. Any reasons you have for thinking that such beliefs correctly represent the world are undermined by the fact that you could have such beliefs even if the external world did not exist. Since the seventeenth century, epistemology has been trying to find a solution to this Cartesian scepticism. This article simply assumes that we can have justification for our perceptual beliefs and that perceptual knowledge is possible. Given this assumption, the focus is on how we should conceive of such justification.

2. Perception, Justification and Causation

Perceptual experience provides both causal and justificatory grounding for our perceptual beliefs and for our knowledge of the passing show. In this section, we shall start to look at the causal and justificatory relations between perception, belief and knowledge. As was discussed above, our perceptual experience can be conceptually structured: we can see the world as being a certain way, or we can see that it is thus and so. Thus, such experience could be seen as providing justification for our perceptual knowledge in that you could be justified in taking things to have the properties you see them as having. The fact that perceptual experience is conceptual, however, is not sufficient to ensure that your perceptual beliefs are justified. Dave, a friend of yours, sees every tackle made against a player of West Ham United Football Club as a foul. He is not, however, justified in taking this to be true. Often these clashes are simply not fouls; Dave is wrong, and even when he is correct, when he really sees that a foul has been committed, it would seem that his prejudiced observation of the game entails that in these cases he only gets it right through luck, and thus, he is not justified in his belief. The fact, then, that our experience is conceptual does not entail that we have justified perceptual beliefs or knowledge. Section 3 considers what else needs to be said, and investigates an account of how perceptual experience is seen to provide epistemic justification. First, though, consider an account of perceptual knowledge that does not make use of the notion of justification.

a. Armstrong’s Causal Account of Perceptual Knowledge

Armstrong (1961 / 1973) claims that perceptual knowledge simply requires that one’s perceptual beliefs stand in lawlike relations to the world.

What makes…a belief a case of knowledge? My suggestion is that there must be a lawlike connection between the state of affairs Bap [that a believes p] and the state of affairs that makes ‘p’ true such that, given Bap, it must be the case that p. (Armstrong, 1973, p. 75)

Crudely, since causal relations are lawlike, if our perceptual and cognitive apparatus is such that it is buzzing flies that cause us to have perceptual beliefs about buzzing flies, then it will be the case that we will have perceptual knowledge of this annoying aspect of our environment when the bees cause the belief. Armstrong calls his account a “thermometer model” of knowledge. We can come to have knowledge of the world just as a thermometer can come to represent its own temperature. In both systems, there is simply a lawlike relation between a property of the world and a property of a representative device (the level of mercury in a thermometer or the state of certain internal cognitive mechanisms of a thinker).

Highlighting the role of perceptual experience, Armstrong claims that:

“perception is nothing but the acquiring of knowledge of, or, on occasions, the acquiring of an inclination to believe in, particular facts about the physical world, by means of our senses,” (Armstrong, 1961, p. 105)

He does, however, claim that there is a “contingent connection between perception and certain sorts of sensation,” and that this, “may help to explain the special ‘feel’ of perception,” (Armstrong, 1961, p. 112). Conscious sensation, then, is not essential to perception. I could be correctly said to see the road ahead as I drive late at night on the motorway, even though I have “switched off,” and appear to be driving on “autopilot.” I can see the road because I am still causally acquiring beliefs about the world in front of me by way of my senses. Similarly, cases of blindsight are also bonafide cases of perception. Blindsight patients claim to have a complete lack of visual experience on, for example, their left side, yet they can make reliable reports about shapes and objects that are presented to this side of their perceptual field (they themselves, however, claim that they are merely guessing). They do, then, seem to be acquiring correct beliefs about their environment via a causal engagement between the world and their senses, and thus, they perceive the world even though in such cases the contingent connections with sensation are lost. Thus, on Armstrong’s account, perceptual experience is not necessary for perceptual knowledge. When one does have conscious perceptual experiences, these do not play a justificatory role; they are simply causally related to perceptual belief and knowledge. Many, however, find such an account too sparse, in that one’s experience does not play any justificatory or epistemic role in the acquisition of perceptual beliefs or knowledge. It is claimed that a more satisfying theory of perception should include an account of why perceptual experience justifies our perceptual beliefs and that we should not be content with simply an account of why we are caused to acquire them. The following theory of perception attempts to include just such an account of justification.

3. Perception and Foundationalism

Foundationalists claim that the superstructure of our belief system inherits its justification from a certain subset of perceptual beliefs upon which the rest sits. These beliefs are termed “basic beliefs.” Our belief system, then, is seen as having the architecture of a building. Later, in section 4, we shall see that coherentists take our belief system to be more akin to an ecosystem, with our beliefs mutually supporting each other, rather than relying for their justification on certain crucial foundation stones. There are various versions of this foundationalist approach, two of which are discussed in the next two sections.

a. Traditional Foundationalism

Traditionally the foundations of knowledge have been seen as infallible (they cannot be wrong), incorrigible (they cannot be refuted), and indubitable (they cannot be doubted). For empiricists, these foundations consist in your beliefs about your own experience. Your beliefs are basic and non-basic. Your basic beliefs comprise such beliefs as that you are now seeing a red shape in your visual field, let us say, and that you are aware of a pungent smell. In order to justify your non-basic belief that Thierry Henry is the best striker in Europe, you must be able to infer it from other beliefs, say that he has scored the most goals. The traditional foundationalist claim, however, is that this sort of inferential justification is not required for your basic beliefs. There may not actually be a red object in the world because you may be hallucinating, but, nevertheless, you cannot be wrong about the fact that you now believe that you am seeing something red. Justification for such beliefs is provided by experiential states that are not themselves beliefs, that is, by your immediate apprehension of the content of your sensory, perceptual experience, or what is sometimes termed, “the Given”. It is, then, your experience of seeing red that justifies your belief that you are seeing red. Such experience is non-conceptual. It is, though, the raw material which you then go on to have conceptual thoughts about. This conception of the relation between knowledge and experience has had a distinguished history. It was advocated by the British empiricists–Locke, Berkeley and Hume–and by the important modern adherents C. I. Lewis (1946) and R. Chisholm (1989). However, this conception of how your perceptual beliefs are justified has been widely attacked, and the next two sections address the most influential arguments against traditional foundationalism.

b. Sellars and the Myth of the Given

Sellars (1956) provides an extended critique of the notion of the Given. There are two parts to Sellars’ argument: first, he claims that knowledge is part of the “logical space of reasons;” and second, he provides an alternative account of “looks talk,” or an alternative reading of such claims as “that looks red to me,” claims that traditionally have been seen as infallible and as foundations for our perceptual knowledge. According to Sellars, no cognitive states are non-inferentially justified. For him:

“The essential part is that in characterising an episode or a state as that of knowing, we are placing it in the logical space of reasons, of justifying and being able to justify what one says.” (Sellars, 1956, p. 76)

Whether we are talking about perceptual or non-perceptual knowledge, we must be able to offer reasons for why we take such claims to be true. To even claim appropriately that I have knowledge that I now seem to be seeing a red shape, I must be able to articulate such reasons as, “since my eyes are working fine, and the light is good, I am right in thinking that I am having a certain sensory experience.” As Rorty (1979, chapter 4) argues, justification is essentially a linguistic or “conversational” notion; it must consist in the reasoned recognition of why a particular belief is likely to be true or why one is rightly said to be having a certain experience. If such an account of justification is correct, then the notion of non-inferentially justified basic beliefs is untenable and non-conceptual perceptual experience cannot provide the justification for our perceptual beliefs.

Surely, though, “this looks red to me,” cannot be something that I can be wrong about. Such a foundationalist claim seems to be undeniable. Sellars, however, suggests that such wording does not indicate infallibility. One does not say, “This looks red to me,” to (infallibly) report the nature of one’s experience; rather, one uses such a locution in order to flag that one is unsure whether one has correctly perceived the world.

… when I say “X looks green to me”…the fact that I make this report rather than the simple report “X is green,” indicates that certain considerations have operated to raise, so to speak in a higher court, the question ‘to endorse or not to endorse.’ I may have reason to think that X may not after all be green. (Sellars, 1956, p. 41)

Thus, Sellars provides a two-pronged attack on traditional foundationalism. The way we describe our perceptual experience does indeed suggest that we have infallible access to certain private experiences, private experiences that we cannot be mistaken about. However, we should recognize the possibility that we may be being fooled by grammar here. Sellars gives an alternative interpretation of such statements as, “this looks red to me,” an interpretation that does not commit one to having such a privileged epistemological access to one’s perceptual experience. Further, a conceptual analysis of “knowledge” reveals that knowledge is essentially a rational state and, therefore, that one cannot claim to know what one has no reason for accepting as true. Such reasons must be conceived in terms of linguistic constructions that one can articulate, and thus, the bare presence of the Given cannot ground the knowledge we have of our own experience or, consequently, of the world. This, then, is a rejection of the traditional foundationalist picture, or what Sellars calls, “the Myth of the Given.”

One of the forms taken by the Myth of the Given is the idea that there is, indeed must be, a structure of particular matter of such fact that (a) each fact can not only be noninferentially known to be the case, but presupposes no other knowledge either of particular matters of fact, or of general truths; and (b) such that the noninferential knowledge of facts belonging to this structure constitutes the ultimate court of appeal for all factual claims, particular and general, about the world. (Sellars, 1956, pp. 68-9)

c. Concepts and Experience

According to traditional foundationalism, the content of perceptual experience, the Given, is not conceptual in nature. It has been argued, however, that experience should not be seen in this traditional way. The phenomenon of “seeing as,” suggests to some that experience should be interpreted as essentially conceptual in nature.

What is this a picture of?

duck-rabbit

You perhaps see a duck. I can, however, alter the character of your visual experience by changing the beliefs that you have about this picture. Think RABBIT looking upward. The picture now looks different to you even though you are seeing the same configuration of black marks on a white background. This picture is usually referred to as “the duck-rabbit.” Originally, you saw the drawing as a duck; now you see it as a rabbit (or, as Wittgenstein would say, you notice different “aspects” of the picture). You have, then, distinct perceptual experiences dependent on the particular concepts “through which” you see that picture. Some take this to prove that perceptual experience is not pre- or non-conceptual but that it is essentially a conceptual engagement with the world. Such experience does not only consist in our having certain retinal images: “There is more to seeing than meets the eyeball,” (Hanson, 1988, p. 294). It is, rather, the result of a necessary conceptual ordering of our perceptual engagement with the world. This is a theory of experience that is at odds with that of the traditional foundationalist.

The theory has Kantian roots. For Kant, one cannot experience the world without having a conceptual structure to provide the representational properties of such experience. In Kant’s terms, the intuitions received by the sensibility cannot be isolated from the conceptualization carried out by the understanding. As he states, “Intuitions without concepts are blind, concepts without intuitions are empty” (Kant, 1781, A51 / B75). Intuitions, or what we might call bare perceptual experience–that which does not have a conceptual structure–cannot be seen as experience of a world, and therefore, such a conception of our perceptual engagement with the world cannot be seen as experiential at all; it is “blind”. The second clause of Kant’s aphorism claims that concepts that are not based on information received through the senses can have no empirical content. The Kantian claim, then, is that thinking about the world and experiencing it are interdependent. This is an attack on the distinction drawn in section 1a between simple seeing and conceptually structured forms of perception such as seeing that and seeing as. Kant claims the notion of simple seeing is incoherent since such a non-conceptual engagement with the world isn’t experiential.

Not everyone accepts that the phenomenon of seeing as entails this picture of experience. Dretske (1969) argues that simple or non-epistemic seeing is independent of epistemic seeing; that is, it is independent of seeing that is conceptually structured. Non-epistemic seeing amounts to the ability to visually differentiate aspects of one’s environment such as the bus stop and the waste bin, and one can do this without seeing these items as anything in particular (although, of course, one usually does). Further, “seeing as” presupposes simple seeing. One has to have some bare experience to provide the raw materials for our conceptually structured experience or thought. We may be able to see the picture above as a duck or as a rabbit, but we can only do this if we have a non-conceptual experience of a certain configuration of black marks on a white background. One’s experience of the basic black and white lines in the figure is independent of any concepts one may have that may then allow one to see these lines in a certain more sophisticated way, that is, as a duck or as a rabbit. In reply, however, it could be claimed that even such a basic experience as this relies on the contingent fact that one has the concepts of, for example, BLACK and WHITE. Perhaps if one did not have these concepts, then one could not even see this basic figure.

We have, then, looked at two problems faced by the traditional foundationalist, both of which center on the alleged non-conceptual nature of perceptual experience. Two responses have been made by those who feel the force of these objections: some modify foundationalism in order to take account of some of the considerations above, and others reject it altogether. The first of these responses is the topic of the next section.

d. Modest Foundationalism

Some foundationalists agree that the Given is in some ways problematic, yet they still attempt to maintain a “modest” or “moderate” foundationalism. Audi (2003) and Plantinga (2000) promote this view. First, our perceptual beliefs concerning both the world and our own experience are not seen as infallible. You can believe that you see red or that you seem to see red, yet either belief could turn out to be unjustified. Second, non-conceptual perceptual experience does not play a justificatory role. Perceptual beliefs are simply self-justified; that is, it is reasonable to accept that they are true unless we have evidence to suggest that they may be untrustworthy. Such a view of perception remains foundationalist in nature because we still have basic beliefs, beliefs that are non-inferentially justified. Thus, the justification possessed by perceptual beliefs is defeasible. You may, for example, have good evidence that your cup of tea has been spiked with an hallucinogen, and, therefore, the justification for your perceptual belief that a pig has just flown past the window is defeated. More controversially, your belief that you seem to see red could be defeated by psychological evidence concerning your confused or inattentive state of mind. However, in the absence of any beliefs concerning such contravening evidence, your perceptual beliefs have prima facie justification.

Modest foundationalism avoids a dilemma that faces traditional foundationalism. It is certainly plausible that beliefs about your own perceptual experience are infallible and that you can’t be wrong when you claim that the cup looks red. It is not clear, however, how such beliefs can ground your perceptual knowledge since they are about your own mental states and not the world. The fact that the cup looks red to you does of course relate to the cup, but primarily it is a fact about how that cup strikes your experience. Recoiling from such a picture, you could claim that your foundational beliefs concern the color of the cup and not merely your experience of the cup. However, it is not plausible that your beliefs about the color of the cup are infallible, and therefore, such beliefs cannot play a foundational role according to the traditional account. The modest foundationalist can avoid this dilemma. For a perceptual belief to be justified, it does not have to be infallible. You can, therefore, have beliefs about the properties of objects in the world playing the requisite foundational role rather than those that are simply about your own experiences.

4. Perception and Coherentism

Modest foundationalists attempt to keep some of the features of the traditional foundationalist picture while conceding that their foundations aren’t infallible. There is, however, a distinct response to the problems associated with traditional foundationalism, and that is to reject its key feature, namely its reliance on foundational, non-inferential, basic beliefs. Coherentism presents an alternative. Coherentists such as Bonjour (1985) and Lehrer (1990) claim that beliefs can only be justified by other beliefs and that this is also true of our perceptual beliefs. Section 3.a described how Sellars argued for such a position in that, for him, perceptual beliefs must be supported by beliefs about the reliability of our experience. The next two sections explain the coherentist account of justifying perceptual claims.

a. The Basic Idea Behind Coherentism

For a coherentist, a particular belief is justified if one’s set of beliefs is more coherent with this belief as a member, and, conversely, a belief is unjustified if the coherence of one’s set of beliefs is increased by dropping that particular belief. The basic idea behind coherentism is that the better a belief system “hangs together,” the more coherent it is. How, though, should we conceive of “hanging together” or “coherence”? First, one requires consistency. Our beliefs should not clash; they must not be logically inconsistent: we should not believe p and believe that not p. However, more than mere logical consistency is required. One could imagine a set of beliefs that consisted of the belief that 2+2=4, the belief that Cher is a great actress, and the belief that yellow clashes with pink. Although these beliefs are logically consistent, they do not form a particularly coherent belief set since they do not have any bearing on each other at all. For coherence, therefore, some kind of positive connection between one’s beliefs is also required. Such a positive connection is that of inference. A maximally coherent belief set is one that is logically consistent and one within which the content of any particular belief can be inferred from the content of certain other beliefs that one holds. Conversely, the coherence of a set of beliefs is reduced if there are subgroups of beliefs that are inferentially isolated from the whole.

b. Bonjour and the Spontaneous Nature of Perceptual Beliefs

For a coherentist, perceptual beliefs are justified, as all beliefs are, if our acceptance of them leads to an increase in the overall coherence of our belief system. An account, though, is also required of how perceptual beliefs can be seen as correctly representing the external world, a world that is independent of our thinking. This is particularly pressing for the coherentist because the justification for our perceptual beliefs is provided by one’s other beliefs and not by one’s perceptual experience of one’s environment.

To account for the representational ability of perceptual beliefs, Bonjour focuses upon a class of beliefs that he calls “cognitively spontaneous.” These are beliefs we simply acquire without inference. Right now, on turning my head to the left, I spontaneously acquire the belief that the orange stapler is in front of the blue pen, and that my glass of water is half full. These perceptual beliefs are likely to be true when certain conditions obtain–that the light is good and that I am not too far away from what I am looking at (these Bonjour calls the “C-conditions”). My belief, then, that my glass is half full is only justified if I also have beliefs about the obtaining of C-conditions. However, for Bonjour’s account to be persuasive, he needs to provide some justification for this claim that beliefs acquired in the C-conditions are likely to be true representations of the world. This he does. First, we do not arrive at them via inference; they are spontaneous. Second, the beliefs that we acquire in this way exhibit a very high measure of coherence and consistency with each other and with the rest of our belief system. The question arises, then, as to why this should be so, since it is not obvious why such spontaneous beliefs should continue to cohere so well. If, for example, these beliefs were randomly produced by our perceptual mechanisms, then our set of beliefs would very soon be disrupted. Bonjour’s claim is that there is a good a priori explanation for the ongoing coherence and consistency of our set of beliefs, that is, that it is the result of our beliefs being caused by a coherent and consistent world. Thus, our perceptual beliefs correctly represent a world that is independent of our thinking. Non-conceptual perceptual experience does not play a justificatory role with respect to perception. This experience may cause us to acquire certain beliefs about our environment, but the justification for these perceptual beliefs is provided by the inferential relations that hold between these beliefs and the rest of our belief system.

There are important objections. Plantinga (1993) notes that in the Cartesian skeptical scenarios we also have a coherent set of beliefs, but in these cases they are caused not by a coherent and consistent world but by an evil demon or by a mad scientist who manipulates a brain that lies in a vat of nutrient fluid (see Descartes 1641 and Putnam 1981). Bonjour’s claim, however, is that it is a priori more probable that our beliefs are not caused by these creatures. Plantinga finds such reasoning “monumentally dubious.”

Even if such a hypothesis [that concerning the claim that our coherent belief system corresponds to a coherent world] and these skeptical explanations do have an a priori probability…it’s surely anyone’s guess what that probability might be. Assuming there is such a thing as a priori probability, what would be the a priori probability of our having been created by a good God who…would not deceive us? What would be the a priori probability of our having been created by an evil demon who delights in deception? And which, if either, would have the greater a priori probability?…how could we possibly tell? (Plantinga, 1993, p. 109)

5. Externalism

The varieties of foundationalism and coherentism examined so far share a certain approach to questions concerning epistemic justification. They ask whether the evidence available to you is sufficient to justify the beliefs that you hold. Questions of justification are approached from the first person perspective. Foundationalists claim that you have justified perceptual beliefs because of the fact that these beliefs are grounded in your perceptual experience, experience that is, of course, accessible to you; it is something of which you are aware, something that you can reflect upon. Coherentists find justification in the inferential relations that hold between your perceptual and non-perceptual beliefs, relations that are, again, something to which you have cognitive access. Epistemic practices can, however, also be assessed from the third person perspective. It can be asked whether a person’s methods do, in fact, lead him or her to have true beliefs about the world, whether or not such reliability is something of which they are aware. Externalists claim that it is this perspective with which epistemology should be concerned. A key notion for externalists is that of reliability. A belief is justified if it is acquired using a method that is reliable, with reliability being cashed out in terms of the probability that one’s thinking latches onto the truth.

The justificatory status of a belief is a function of the reliability of the processes that cause it, where (as a first approximation) reliability consists in the tendency of a process to produce beliefs that are true rather than false. (Goldman, 1979, p. 10)

One need not be able to tell by reflection alone whether or not one’s thinking is reliable in the required sense; a thinker does not have to be aware of what it is that justifies his or her beliefs.

According to a reliabilist, then, a perceptual belief is justified if it is the product of reliable perceptual processes. One strategy that reliabilists have adopted is to ground their account of reliability in terms of the causal connections that thinkers have to the world. Roughly, for one to have a justified perceptual belief that p, the fact that p should cause my belief that p. I am justified in believing that Frasier is on television because its presence on the screen causes my belief. Such accounts are developed by Goldman (1979 / 1986) and Dretske (1981). It is important to note the difference between this kind of account and that of Armstrong (section 2a). Armstrong eschews all talk of justification and provides a wholly causal account of perceptual knowledge. Many externalists, however, give an account of justification in causal terms.

It was assumed throughout this article, except during the discussion of scepticism, that we do have perceptual knowledge of the world, and the article explored the multifarious epistemic and causal relations that there are between the various modes of perception and perceptual knowledge. Justification is the key issue, and there are four basic stances. One stance is to agree with Armstrong and deny that perceptual experience plays any justificatory role. Foundationalists see perceptual experience as the justificatory basis for perceptual knowledge, and it is such experience that ultimately provides justification for all our knowledge of the world. Problems with the traditional form of this position urged us to explore a more modest form of foundationalism. Others reject foundationalism altogether. Coherentists claim that the justification for our perceptual beliefs is a function of how well those beliefs “hang together” with the rest of our belief system. They too reject the justificatory role of perceptual experience. Some externalists claim that justification is a matter of reliability and that so long as our perceptual beliefs are produced by mechanisms that reliably give us true beliefs, then those beliefs are justified. Therefore, perception is of prime epistemological importance, and it remains the focus of lively philosophical debate.

6. References and Further Reading

Armstrong, D. M. ‘The Thermometer Theory of Knowledge’ in S. Bernecker & F. Dretske, eds. Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology, Oxford University Press, Oxford, pp. 72-85, 2000. Originally published in Armstrong, 1973, pp. 162-75, 178-83.
Armstrong, D. M. Belief, Truth and Knowledge, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1973.
Armstrong, D. M. Perception and the Physical World, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1961.
- Included in the above is Armstrong’s causal account of perception.
Audi, R. “Contemporary Modest Foundationalism,” in Pojman, L. ed. The Theory of Knowledge: Classical and Contemporary Readings, Wadsworth, Belmont, CA. 3rd edition, 2003.
- A useful paper in which it is argued that modest foundationalism has advantages over traditional foundationalism.
Bonjour, L. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1985.
- A well-developed coherentist theory of justification which includes an account of the role of perception within such a theory. (One should note, however, that Bonjour has recently abandoned coherentism in favour of a version of foundationalism.)
Chisholm, R. M. Theory of Knowledge, 3rd edition, Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey, 1989.
- A wide ranging study of various epistemological issues including his version of traditional foundationalism.
Descartes, R. “First Meditation,” in Meditations on First Philosophy, 1641. Reprinted in The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, eds. J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1983.
- One of the most influential passages of epistemological writing in the history of Western philosophy in which various skeptical possibilities are raised that suggest that our perceptual beliefs may not be justified.
Dretske, F. Seeing and Knowing, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1969.
- Dretske defends the claim that seeing can be seen as non-conceptual (or non-epistemic).
Dretske, F. Knowledge and the Flow of Information, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1981.
- Here he presents his sophisticated version of reliabilism.
Goldman, A. I. “What is Justified Belief?,” in G. Pappas, ed. Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology, Reidel, pp. 1-23, 1979.
Goldman, A.I. Epistemology and Cognition, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1986.
- In the above, Goldman forwards his reliabilist account of justification.
Grice, H. P. “The Causal Theory of Perception,” in Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
- A precursor to the various contemporary causal theories of perception, presented in the context of a sense datum theory of perception.
Hanson, N. R. “From Patterns of Discovery,” in Perception, R. Schwartz, ed. pp. 292- 305, 1988.
- Hansen argues that the nature of our perceptual experience depends on the concepts we possess.
Kant, I. The Critique of Pure Reason, trans. N. Kemp Smith, 1929 edition, The Macmillan Press, Ltd. Basingstoke, Hampshire, 1781.
- One of the greatest and most influential works of modern philosophy. Of relevance to this article are Kant’s thoughts concerning the relation between our conceptual framework and the nature of our perceptual experience.
Lehrer, K. Theory of Knowledge, Westview Press, Boulder, Colorado, 1990.
- Lehrer provides a critique of foundationalism and his own developed version of coherentism.
Lewis, C. I. An Analysis of Knowledge and Evaluation, La Salle, Illinois, 1946.
- Amongst various other important epistemological issues, one can find Lewis’s account of traditional foundationalism.
McDowell, J. Mind and World, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1994.
- In this transcription of his Locke lectures, McDowell argues that perceptual experience is essentially conceptual in nature.
Plantinga, A. Warrant: The Current Debate, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1993.
- An excellent epistemology textbook which includes an in-depth critique of Bonjour’s coherentism.
Plantinga, A. Warranted Christian Belief, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 2000.
- In the context of a sophisticated discussion of the philosophy of religion, Plantinga develops a version of modest foundationalism which he calls “reformed epistemology”.
Putnam, H. Reason, Truth and History, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1981.
- In chapter 1, Putnam presents his contemporary brain in a vat version of the Cartesian skeptical scenario.
Rorty, R. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature, Princetown University Press, Princetown, 1979.
- A historically informed and extended attack on traditional foundationalism.
Schwartz, R. Perception, Blackwell, Oxford, 1988.
- A good collection of articles focused on the epistemology of perception.
Sellars, W. Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind. Originally published in H. Feigl and M. Scrivens, eds. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. 1, University of Minnesota Press, Minneapolis, pp. 253-329, 1956. Page numbers here refer to 1997 reprint, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass.
- This includes Sellars’ influential attack on the Given.

Author Information

Daniel O’Brien
Email: D.Obrien@bham.ac.uk
The University of Birmingham
U. S. A.

Johann Christian Friedrich Hölderlin (1770—1843)

Holderlin Although J. C. F. Hölderlin has, since the beginning of the twentieth century, enjoyed the reputation of being one of Germany’s greatest poets, his recognition as an important philosophical figure is more recent. The revival of an interest in German Idealism, and the philosophical developments from Kant’s critical period to Hegel’s mature thought, have ensured that Hölderlin is given his due for his important philosophical insights. Hölderlin’s life was marked by theological training, together with Hegel and Schelling, followed by a period of simultaneous philosophical and poetic activity. Eventually, Hölderlin concentrated on poetry as a superior form of access to the truth. His theoretical philosophy is marked by an anti-foundationalist rebuttal of Fichte’s first principle. The key idea is that nothing can be said about what grounds the possibility of the subject-object relation, a primordial unity which Hölderlin calls Absolute Being. This central idea was crucial to the development of Schelling’s thought. Hölderlin’s ethical views emphasize an understanding of life as torn between two principles: a hankering after this original unity and freedom’s desire to constantly assert itself. His novel Hyperion illustrates this struggle and how the integration of these two principles is set as a goal for life. The superiority of poetry over philosophy in pointing to the truth is suggested through this novel plus several poems, and this theme was of particular interest for Heidegger’s later thought.

Overview
Life and Philosophical Background
Unity and Freedom
The Self and Human Life
Hölderlin’s Influence
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Overview

Johann Christian Friedrich Hölderlin is well known as a key figure of German romantic poetry. This recognition was, however, late to come, and it is chiefly in the first half of the twentieth century that he acquires his status as one of Germany’s greatest poets, and, in particular, became a key figure in Heidegger’s later thought. Hölderlin’s own contribution to philosophy, both in theoretical and literary form, has taken much longer to be acknowledged. It is of great importance, however, both for an understanding of the development of German Idealism and in relation to contemporary philosophical issues. Although Hölderlin left little published material of direct philosophical relevance, his personal acquaintance with Schiller, Novalis, Fichte, Schelling and Hegel ensured the dissemination of his ideas among his immediate contemporaries. In the second half of the twentieth century, two factors have been decisive in the renewed interest in Hölderlin as a philosopher. On the one hand, there has been a striking growth of scholarship in the philosophy that marks the transition from Kant to Hegel, chiefly through philosophers such as Dieter Henrich and Manfred Frank. On the other, a short philosophical text came to light in 1961, which for the first time presented key central tenets of Hölderlin’s thought in a concise form.

2. Life and Philosophical Background

Hölderlin was born in 1770 in Swabia in South-Western Germany. He studied theology and was originally destined for a career in the Lutheran church. His studies eventually took him, at the age of eighteen, to the famous Tübingen seminary where he studied with Hegel, as well as with his old school friend Schelling. Hölderlin came to Jena in 1794, after Fichte had taken over the chair of philosophy from Reinhold. During that period, Hölderlin was a staunch supporter of the French Revolution, which was seen by many German intellectuals as a source of hope for the future. Hölderlin found a position as a private tutor and fell passionately in love with his pupils’ mother, Susette Gontard. She was to be the inspiration behind the Diotima of his novel Hyperion. The emotional upheaval caused by the end of the impossible liaison with Susette had a detrimental effect on his health. In 1800, after his disillusionment with philosophy that led him to abandon any plans to find an academic position, he spent a year recovering in Switzerland and decided to devote the rest of his life to writing poetry. In 1802, the news of Susette’s death, however, drove him to near insanity. Treatment enabled him to continue writing at intervals while working as a librarian in Homburg until 1807 when he became insane (though harmless). In 1805, he was one of a group of Jacobin militants, led by his friend Isaac von Sinclair, involved in a conspiracy against the Elector of Württemberg. Hölderlin was accused of high treason, but thereafter was released on grounds of diminished mental capacity. He was taken to Tübingen where he lived until his death in 1843. Some form of poetic output continued in Tübingen, although these later poems are significantly marked by Hölderlin’s mental illness.

Hölderlin’s original philosophical thought emerged before his move to Jena: the main poetic work of philosophical interest, Hyperion, was started in Tübingen in 1792, and after the publication of a fragment in Schiller’s review Thalia, the full work was later published in two volumes in Jena. It is, however, in Jena that Hölderlin’s philosophical ideas took their definitive form, partly as a result of its bustling intellectual climate.

The philosophical background to his philosophical ideas can be traced back to Reinhold’s lectures and publications on Kant’s philosophy in the late 1780’s and early 1790’s. Reinhold, who was one of the main expositors of Kantian critical thought of that period, developed a philosophical system essentially aimed at providing Kant’s critical philosophy with a first principle. The need to underpin Kant’s system with such a ground was to prove a fundamental, but contentious, issue for the philosophical developments of the 1790’s in Germany.

Fichte echoed some of the criticisms that were to be addressed in the specifics of Reinhold’s first principle, the principle of consciousness (e.g. in Schulze’s Aenesidemus, see Giovanni and Harris, 2000), but agreed with the need for such a grounding and set out to provide his own first principle instead. The resulting system, the Wissenschaftslehre (Doctrine of science), first published in 1794, was Fichte’s attempt to develop a philosophical doctrine that would respect the spirit, if not the letter, of Kant’s critical philosophy. The first principle of this philosophy expressed a relation of the I to itself: “The I posits its own being unconditionally” (Fichte, 1994). Against any such grounding attempts, the circle of Jena philosophers around Niethammer claimed, in line with earlier criticism of Kant by Jacobi, that such an enterprise was flawed in principle; since any principle requires justification beyond itself, an infinite regress ensues. As a result, philosophy, for Niethammer’s circle, is an unending enterprise that approaches the truth but can never reach it.

This anti-foundationalist line became Hölderlin’s when he rejected Fichte’s philosophy in the mid-1790s, but the philosophical ideas that Hölderlin developed during this period were also motivated by other concerns. To understand these, we must turn to moral philosophy. Kant’s ethics had a profound influence on many writers of the time, and Schiller’s response is particularly important. In 1793, Schiller showed enthusiasm for Kant’s ethics of duty while querying the rigorism which some Kantian statements strongly suggest. Hence, Schiller’s famous joke that it seems Kant prefers the agent who would do his duty with displeasure, to one whose inclinations are in line with the commands of the moral law. Schiller claimed that a harmony of duty and inclination represented the highest ideal of morality, while Kant found inclinations to be worthless. In his letters, “On the Aesthetic Education of Man” (Schiller, 1982), he argues for the moral value of the aesthetic ideal of grace (Anmut). For Schiller, “grace” describes the moral beauty of an agent whose emotions have been educated by reason. Given Schiller’s endorsement of the basic tenets of Kant’s ethics, this notion of the “beautiful soul” is problematic. Indeed, it implies a purported reconciliation between the sublimity that attaches to the dutiful agent who, in his freedom, places the moral law above all inclinations, and the beauty of a harmony of inclinations and duty. Since the moral law, however, requires that the agent act out of duty regardless of what inclines her, this is hardly compatible with an ideal of harmony between duty and inclinations. As a result of the tension between the freedom of the moral agent and this ideal of harmony, the cogency of the proposed moral value of the beautiful soul becomes questionable.

3. Unity and Freedom

Hölderlin, in fact, sees these two aspects of human life, the “all-desiring, all-subjugating dangerous side of man,” i.e. freedom, and the “most beautiful condition he can achieve,” i.e. unity (preface to Hyperion in Thalia, 1794) as representing the essence of the human condition. This accounts for his understanding of human life as man’s “eccentric path”: an unreflective unity constitutes the core of our existence, but we cannot remain within it. Rather, it becomes something we strive towards with our freedom.

With this bi-polarity in mind, we can now appreciate Hölderlin’s contribution to the theoretical debate around Fichte’s attempts to find a foundational principle for philosophy. Fichte had proposed to ground philosophy on the pure relation of the I to itself. In Über Urtheil und Seyn (On Judgment and Being), a short manuscript that was only first published in 1961 (Hölderlin, 1972), Hölderlin points out that subjectivity cannot provide the first principle of philosophy since the I is always defined in relation to an object of judgment. This criticism of Fichte’s system may appear unfair as, in the 1797 edition of the Doctrine of Knowledge, he does discuss the fact that there must be a pre-reflective form of self-awareness. However, Fichte does not draw all the consequences from this observation. Hölderlin’s point is that such self-consciousness cannot be accounted for in terms of the I of judgment. The ground for the I’s reflective self-consciousness must, thus, be sought beyond the division between the subject ‘I’ and an object which this presupposes. Such a ground, Hölderlin calls “absolute Being.” This is, moreover, the ground for all judgments in which the subject ‘I’ is distinguished from an object.

An original unity of subject and object in Being is what underpins their separation in judgment. Hölderlin, thus, defines Being as follows: “Where Subject and Object are absolutely, not just partially united…there and not otherwise can we talk of an absolute Being, as is the case in intellectual intuition (ibid., p. 515).” He understands judgment as the original cleavage of object from subject: “Judgment: is in the highest and strictest sense the original sundering of Subject and Object most intimately united in intellectual intuition, the very sundering which first makes Object and Subject possible (ibid., p.516).” Of Being, no further knowledge is possible. It is only known as the original unity that underpins all judgments. It, therefore, functions as a postulated ground rather than as a first principle.

4. The Self and Human Life

In terms of the understanding of the self, there are two types of self-awareness. In one sense, when I reflect upon myself, I am distinct from the object of my awareness. In another, I must understand myself as belonging to an original pre-reflective unity. The first provides the ground for the freedom of the I to raise itself above anything that is given in the empirical world. The second provides the self with an ideal of unity characterised by a belonging to Being. The “eccentric path” of life is, therefore, torn between these two poles of unity and freedom. The latter takes us away from the original unity while being grounded in it. The task of integrating the two poles in one’s life is that of bringing freedom to recognize the greater unity of Being, but this can only be a progressive and never-ending enterprise.

The novel Hyperion presents different practical approaches to dealing with the bi-polarity of the “eccentric path.” This novel is a collection of letters, mostly written by the novel’s modern Greek hero, Hyperion, to his German friend, Bellarmin, in which he recounts his adventures, states of mind, and longings. The original unity which Hyperion was, from the outset, keen to recapture, is understood in different ways by Hyperion at different stages of his life. Ultimately, he will realize that none of these is satisfactory, but that they represented ways of approaching that which is the underlying unity, i.e. Being, throughout the course of his life.

These different representations of unity are of ancient Greece (also reflected in childhood), of modern Greece liberated from Turkish rule, and of aesthetic beauty. This trilogy is not random but corresponds to different temporal understandings of the idea of the fundamental unity of Being. It is first grasped as belonging to the past (Childhood/Ancient Greece), then the future (liberated Greece), and finally the present (immediacy of aesthetic beauty). Each way of life is exemplified by a character with whom Hyperion is connected, respectively through a master-pupil relationship (Adamas), friendship (Alabanda) and love (Diotima).

In each case, Hyperion attempts to fully adopt the corresponding way of being only to find its limitations and be confronted with the need to move on. Thus, with Adamas, Hyperion feels compelled to leave his master and seek another way of life because of man’s lack of contentment and constant desire to go beyond his current condition: “We delight in flinging ourselves into the night of the unknown, into the cold strangeness of any other world, and, if we could, we would leave the realm of the sun and rush headlong beyond the comet’s track” (Hölderlin, 1990, p. 10) [“Wir haben unsre Lust daran, uns in die Nacht des Unbekannten, in die kalte Fremde irgend einer andern Welt zu stürzen, und wär’ es möglich, wir verlieβen der Sonne Gebiet und stürmten über des Irrsterns Grenzen hinaus” (Hölderlin, 1999, p.492)]. After leaving home and learning about the world, his encounter with Alabanda is that of a soul-mate who has fought his way to freedom. Together, they plan noble and heroic deeds, but Hyperion’s world crumbles when he realizes the dark side of such purported moral ambition. Alabanda’s friends are ruthless revolutionaries who seek to overthrow the present powers by violent means: “The cold sword is forged from hot metal” (ibid., p.26) [“Aus heiβem Metalle wird das kalte Schwert geschmieden” (ibid., p. 510)]. Through this experience, Hyperion grasps something of the conflictual nature of human life: “If the life of the world consists in an alteration between opening and closing, between going forth and returning, why is it not even so with the heart of man” (ibid., p.29) [“Bestehet ja das Leben der Welt im Wechsel des Entfaltens und Vershlieβens, in Ausflug und in Rückkehr zu sich selbst, warum nicht auch das Herz des Menschen” (ibid., p.514)]? However, it is by encountering beauty in the person and life of Diotima (Book II of Volume I) that Hyperion believes he has found what he is looking for, i.e. the Unity he is after: “I have seen it once, the one thing that my soul sought, and the perfection that we put somewhere far away above the stars, that we put off until the end of time – I have felt it in its living presence” (ibid., p.41) [“Ich habe es Einmal gesehen, das Einzige, das meine Seele suchte, und die Vollendung die wir über die Sterne hinauf entfernen, die wir hinausscheben bis ans Ende der Zeit, die hab’ ich gegenwärtig gefühlt” (ibid., p.529)]. A period of bliss ensues, but Diotima understands that Hyperion is “born for higher things” (ibid., p.72) [“zu höhern Dingen geboren” (ibid., p.566)], that the simple harmony of her life is not for him. He must go out and bring beauty to those places where it is lacking. Having grasped this (Book I of Volume II), Hyperion answers Alabanda’s call to join him in battle to free Greece.

Hyperion’s departure for battle is followed by several letters addressed to Diotima and a couple of her replies. After initial success in the fight against the Turks, Hyperion’s men are delayed by the long siege of Mistra. Nonetheless, as they finally enter the town, they go on a]rampage, pillaging and killing indiscriminately. Rather than face the enemy, Hyperion’s army disperses once its lust for plunder is satisfied. This leads to the death of forty Russian soldiers who stood alone fighting the common foe. Hyperion takes his army’s dishonour to make him unworthy, in his eyes, for Diotima’s love: “I must advise you to give me up, my Diotima” (ibid., p.98) [“ich muβ dir raten, daβ du mich verlässest, meine Diotima” (ibid., p.597)]. In letters to Bellarmin, we discover more details of the battles fought by Hyperion and Alabanda. Their friendship flourished again, but Alabanda’s lust for battle eventually came to an end, thus pointing once more to the limits of his way of life. In a letter from Diotima that arrives later, it emerges that she lost her will to live as her lover did not return, and she finally let herself die. In a development which reflects Hölderlin’s understanding of human life, the effortless harmony of Diotima’s world of beauty, once disturbed by the fire of Hyperion’s free aspiration to noble deeds, could not simply return to its original form. Rather, it became something to aim for, something Diotima thought Hyperion could achieve for her: “You drew my life away from the Earth, but you would also have had power to bind me to the Earth” (ibid., p.122) [“Du entzogst main Leben der Erde, du hättest auch Macht gehabt, mich an die Erde zu fesseln” (ibid., p.626)]. It is, thus, through its very destruction, that Diotima’s way of life ceases to represent that which Hyperion could have sought to take refuge in. Diotima’s words illustrate the whole problem of life as an “eccentric path,” but her death, apparently, only leaves Hyperion confused: “as I am now, I have no names for things and all before me is uncertainty” (ibid., p.126) [“wie ich jetzt bin, hab ich keinen Namen für die Dinge, und es ist mir alles ungewiβ” (ibid., p.632)]. At the end of the novel, however, the beauty of Nature once again fills Hyperion with joy, and this poetic sense of oneness reaches beyond separation and death to Alabanda and Diotima. Somehow, he has made some sense of his experiences. Thus, after all these tragedies, an overall feeling of unity prevails: “You springs of earth! you flowers! and you woods and you eagles and you brotherly light! how old and new is our love!- We are free, we are not narrowly alike in outward semblance; how should the Mode of life not vary? yet we love the ether, all of us, and in the inmost of our inmost selves we are alike” (ibid., p.133) [“Ihr Quellen der Erd! Ihr Blumen! Und ihr Wälder und ihr Adler und du brüderliches Licht! Wie alt und neu ist unsere Liebe! – Frei sind wir, gleichen uns nicht ängstig von auβen; wie sollte nicht wechseln die Weise des Lebens? Wir lieben den Äther doch all und innigst im Innersten gleichen wir uns” (ibid., p.639-640)]. However, the last words of the novel suggest an open ending: “So I thought. More soon” (ibid., p.133) [“So dacht’ ich. Nächstens mehr” (ibid., p.640)]. Thus, after all the ordeals that he has worked through in these letters, Hyperion’s life goes on. This seems to point to new experiences and the possibility of revisiting his interpretation of his life thus far.

The poetic contemplation of our oneness with Nature, which is prominent in the novel’s final letter, points to an understanding which philosophy cannot reach. Hyperion hints at this when he complains about the Germans: “Is not the air that you drink in better than your chatter? Are not the sun’s rays nobler than all of you in your cleverness” (ibid., p.129) [“Ist besser, denn euer Geschwätz, die Luft nicht, die ihr trinkt? Der Sonne Strahlen, sind sie edler nicht, denn all’ ihr Klugen” (ibid., p.635)]? Hölderlin’s life confirms his endorsement of the superiority of poetry. After the Jena period, he finally followed the advice his friend Schiller had given him in 1796 and never returned to philosophical argumentation, rather seeking to show something of the greater unity of Being in poetic form.

In line with his understanding of Being as lying beyond our ken, Hölderlin developed a theory of tonal modulations (Wechseltonlehre) that is illustrated in much of his poetic output. According to this theory, there are three fundamental poetic tones: the naïve, the heroic and the ideal. A tone, however, cannot be expressed in its pure form but only through a tension with its medium, a tension created by the work of art. Thus, the poem becomes what Hölderlin calls an “extended metaphor” of what cannot be said directly (Hölderlin, 1990).

5. Hölderlin’s Influence

Because of his small philosophical output, it is important to indicate in what way Hölderlin’s ideas have influenced his contemporaries and later thinkers. It was Hölderlin whose ideas showed Hegel that he could not continue to work on the applications of philosophy to politics without first addressing certain theoretical issues. In 1801, this led Hegel to move to Jena where he was to write the Phenomenology of Spirit. It could be argued, however, that Hegel’s (1977) view of poetry as belonging to the past and his dismissal of the Romantic movement, show a lack of a grasp of the kind of point Hölderlin was making.

Schelling’s early work amounts to a development of Hölderlin’s concept of Being in terms of a notion of a prior identity of thought and object in his Philosophy of Identity (Schelling, 1994). This philosophy apparently makes knowledge of the Absolute (i.e. the absolute ground) impossible, and Schelling wrestles with the possibility of articulating how the Absolute amounts to knowledge of itself in Hegelian fashion. However, his later philosophy clearly distinguishes itself from Hegel’s in that it claims that the ground of the understanding contained in a philosophical system such as Hegel’s is “what is above all understanding” and can, therefore, “never become comprehensible” (ibid., p.162). This endorsement of a claim related to Hölderlin’s about the unknowability of the ultimate ground of conceptual discourse draws to a close the efforts of German Idealism to grasp the whole of reality in conceptual terms. Finally, we must note that Heidegger saw in Hölderlin a prophetic figure, but it was Hölderlin the poet, not the philosopher, whom Heidegger had in mind. In Being and Time, Heidegger first introduces his key idea of the forgetting of the question of Being. His later thought develops this idea which leads to the thought that poetry announces a new clearing of Being. This echoes Hölderlin’s privileging of poetry with respect to conceptual thought. For Heidegger, poetry cannot name the unnameable, but it can keep open the space for it (Heidegger, 1996, 2000). However, Heidegger understands Hölderlin as showing the way to a future clearing of Being. We note that Heidegger’s interpretation is controversial and has been criticised, in particular by Henrich (1992, 1997), for whom Hölderlin is a “recollective” poet. For Henrich, Hölderlin’s work is turned to the past, and to our longings, both for a sense of original unity and for the freedom of the self.

6. Conclusion

Hölderlin’s philosophically relevant output, although very small, is central to a proper understanding of the development of German Idealism from its source in the task of providing a ground for Kant’s critical system to its later attempts to give an all-encompassing philosophical account of reality. Hölderlin’s insights in his theoretical text On Judgment and Being can be seen as relevant to this development. The consequent privileging of poetry over philosophy, of which Hölderlin’s career provides a striking illustration, resonates into the twentieth century in Heidegger’s later thought, but central to Hölderlin’s philosophical contribution is also the practical correlate of his theoretical thought: his novel Hyperion provides a profound insight into his understanding of life’s “eccentric path” as a struggle between the harmony of a lost, original unity and the drive of human beings’ free spirit always to seek the overcoming of any given limits.

7. References and Further Reading

Adorno, T.W. (1992) Parataxis: On Hölderlin’s late poetry, in Adorno, Notes to Literature Vol. 2, transl. S.W.Nicholsen, Columbia University Press, New York, pp. 109-149.
Ameriks, K. (ed.) (2000) The Cambridge Companion to German Idealism, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge.
Constantine, D. (1988) Hölderlin, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Donelan, J.H. (2002) Hölderlin’s poetic self-consciousness, Philosophy and Literature, 26, 125-142.
Fichte, J.G. (1994) Introductions to the Wissenschaftslehre and Other Writings (1797-1800), ed. and transl. D. Breazeale, Hackett, Indianapolis/Cambridge.
Förster, E. (1995) ‘To lend wings to physics once again’: Hölderlin and the ‘Oldest System Program of German Idealism’, European Journal of Philosophy, 3(2), 174-198.
di Giovanni, G. and Harris, H.S., editors, (2000) Between Kant and
Hegel: Texts in the Development of Post- Kantian Idealism, Hackett, Indianapolis.
Hegel, G.W.F. (1977) Phenomenology of Spirit, transl. A.V.Miller, Oxford University Press, Oxford.
Heidegger, M. (2000) Elucidations of Hölderlin’s poetry, transl. K.Hoeller, Humanity Books, New York.
Heidegger, M. (1996) Holderlin’s Hymn “the Ister”, Indiana University Press, Indianapolis.
Henrich, D. (1992) Der Grund im Bewuβtsein: Untersuchungen zu Hölderlin’s Denken, 1794-1795, Klett-Cotta, Stuttgart.
Henrich, D. (1997) The Course of Remembrance and Other Essays on Hölderlin, ed. E. Förster, Stanford University Press, Stanford.
Hölderlin, F. (1972) Über Urtheil und Seyn (On Judgment and Being), in H.S. Harris: ‘Hegel’s Development: Toward the Sunlight 1770-1801’, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Hölderlin, F. (1990) Hyperion and selected poems, ed. Eric L. Santner, Continuum, New York.
Hölderlin, F. (1999) Sämtliche Gedichte und Hyperion, Insel Verlag, Frankfurt-am-Main.
Ryan, L. (1960) Hölderlin’s Lehre vom Wechsel der Töne, Klett-Cotta, Stuttgart.
Schelling, F.W.J. (1994) On the History of Modern Philosophy, transl. A. Bowie, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge.
Schiller, F. (1982) On the Aesthetic Education of Man in a series of letters, ed. & transl. E.M.Wilkinson & L.A. Willoughby, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Waibel, V. (2000) Hölderlin und Fichte: 1794-1800, Paderborn.

Author Information

Christian J. Onof
Email: c.onof@imperial.ac.uk
University of London
United Kingdom

Religious Epistemology

Belief in God, or some form of transcendent Real, has been assumed in virtually every culture throughout human history. The issue of the reasonableness or rationality of belief in God or particular beliefs about God typically arises when a religion is confronted with religious competitors or the rise of atheism or agnosticism. In the West, belief in God was assumed in the dominant Jewish, Christian and Islamic religions. God, in this tradition, is the omnipotent, omniscient, perfectly good and all-loving Creator of the universe (such a doctrine is sometimes called ‘bare theism’). This article considers the following epistemological issues: reasonableness of belief in the Judeo-Christian-Muslim God (“God,” for short), the nature of reason, the claim that belief in God is not rational, defenses that it is rational, and approaches that recommend groundless belief in God or philosophical fideism.

Is belief in God rational? The evidentialist objector says “No” due to the lack of evidence. Theists who say “Yes” fall into two main categories: those who claim that there is sufficient evidence and those who claim that evidence is not necessary. Theistic evidentialists contend that there is enough evidence to ground rational belief in God, while Reformed epistemologists contend that evidence is not necessary to ground rational belief in God (but that belief in God is grounded in various characteristic religious experiences). Philosophical fideists deny that belief in God belongs in the realm of the rational. And, of course, all of these theistic claims are widely and enthusiastically disputed by philosophical non-theists.

Reason/Rationality
The Evidentialist Objection to Belief in God
The Reasonableness of Belief in God
Groundless Believing
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Reason/Rationality

Reason is a fallible human tool for discovering truth or grasping reality. Although reason aims at the truth, it may fall short. In addition, rationality is more a matter of how one believes than what one believes. For example, one might irrationally believe something that is true: suppose one believed that the center of the earth is molten metal because one believes that he or she travels there every night (while it’s cool). And one might rationally believe what is false: it was rational for most people twenty centuries ago to believe that the earth is flat. And finally, rationality is person and situation specific: what is rational for one person at a particular socio-historical time and place might not be rational for another person at a different time and place; or, for that matter, what is rational for a person in the same time and place may be irrational for another person in the same time and place. This has relevance for a discussion of belief in God because “the rationality of religious belief” is typically discussed abstractly, independent of any particular believer and often believed to be settled once and for all either positively or negatively (say, by Aquinas or Hume respectively). The proper question should be, “Is belief in God rational for this person in that time and place?”

Rationality is a normative property possessed by a belief or a believer (although I’ve given reasons in the previous paragraph to suggest that rationality applies more properly to believers than to beliefs). Just precisely what this normative property is is a matter of great dispute. Some believe that we have intellectual duties (for example, to acquire true beliefs and avoid false beliefs, or to believe only on the basis of evidence or argument). Some deny that we have intellectual duties because, by and large, beliefs are not something we freely choose (e.g., look outside at a tree, consider the tree and try to choose not to believe that there’s a tree there; or, close your eyes and if you believe in God, decide not to believe or vice versa and now decide to believe in God again). Since we only have duties when we are free to fulfill or to not fulfill them (“Ought implies can”), we cannot have intellectual duties if we aren’t free to directly choose our beliefs. So, the normative property espoused by such thinkers might be intellectual permissibility rather than intellectual duty.

Since the time of the Enlightenment, reason has assumed a huge role for (valid or strong) inference: rationality is often a matter of assembling available (often empirical, typically propositional) evidence and assessing its deductive or inductive support for other beliefs; although some beliefs may and must be accepted without inference, the vast majority of beliefs or, more precisely, the vast majority of philosophical, scientific, ethical, theological and even common-sensical beliefs rationally require the support of evidence or argument. This view of reason is often taken ahistorically: rationality is simply a matter of timeless and non-person indexed propositional evidence and its logical bearing on the conclusion. If it can be shown that an argument is invalid or weak, belief in its conclusion would be irrational for every person in every time and place. This violates the viable intuition that rationality is person- and situation- specific. Although one argument for belief in God might be invalid, there might be other arguments that support belief in God. Or, supposing all of the propositional evidence for God’s existence is deficient, a person may have religious experience as the grounds of her belief in God.

Following Thomas Reid, we shall argue that ‘rationality’ in many of the aforementioned important cases need not, indeed cannot, require (valid or strong) inference. Our rational cognitive faculties include a wide variety of belief-producing mechanisms, few of which could or should pass the test of inference. We will let this view, and its significance for belief in God, emerge as the discussion proceeds.

2. The Evidentialist Objection to Belief in God

Belief in God is considered irrational for two primary reasons: lack of evidence and evidence to the contrary (usually the problem of evil, which won’t be discussed in this essay). Note that both of these positions reject the rationality of belief in God on the basis of an inference. Bertrand Russell was once asked, if he were to come before God, what he would say to God. Russell replied, “Not enough evidence God, not enough evidence.” Following Alvin Plantinga, we will call the claim that belief in God lacks evidence and is thus irrational the evidentialist objection to belief in God.

The roots of evidentialism may be found in the Enlightenment demand that all beliefs be subjected to the searching criticism of reason; if a belief cannot survive the scrutiny of reason, it is irrational. Kant’s charge is clear: “Dare to use your own reason.” Given increasing awareness of religious options, Hobbes would ask: “If one prophet deceive another, what certainty is there of knowing the will of God, by any other way than that of reason?” Although the Enlightenment elevation of Reason would come to be associated with a corresponding rejection of rational religious belief, many of the great Enlightenment thinkers were themselves theists (including, for example, Kant and Hobbes).

The evidentialist objection may be formalized as follows:

(1) Belief in God is rational only if there is sufficient evidence for the existence of God.

(2) There is not sufficient evidence for the existence of God.

(3) Therefore, belief in God is irrational.

The evidentialist objection is not offered as a disproof of the existence of God—that is, the conclusion is not “God does not exist.” Rather the conclusion is, even if God were to exist, it would not be reasonable to believe in God. According to the evidentialist objection, rational belief in God hinges on the success of theistic arguments. Prominent evidentialist objectors include David Hume, W. K. Clifford, J. L. Mackie, Bertrand Russell and Michael Scriven. This view is probably held by a large majority of contemporary Western philosophers. Ironically, in most areas of philosophy and life, most philosophers are not (indeed could not be) evidentialists. We shall treat this claim shortly.

The claim that there is not sufficient evidence for belief in God is usually based on a negative assessment of the success of theistic proofs or arguments. Following Hume and Kant, the standard arguments for the existence of God—cosmological, teleological and ontological—are judged to be defective in one respect or another.

The claim that rational belief in God requires the support of evidence or argument is usually rooted in a view of the structure of knowledge that has come to be known as ‘classical foundationalism.’ Classical foundationalists take a pyramid or a house as metaphors for their conceptions of knowledge or rationality. A secure house or pyramid must have secure foundations sufficient to carry the weight of each floor of the house and the roof. A solid, enduring house has a secure foundation with each of the subsequent floors properly attached to that foundation. Ultimately, the foundation carries the weight of the house. In a classical foundationalist conception of knowledge, the foundational beliefs must likewise be secure, enduring and adequate to bear “the weight” of all of the non-foundational or higher-level beliefs. These foundational beliefs are characterized in such a manner to ensure that knowledge is built on a foundation of certitudes (following Descartes). The candidates for these foundational certitudes vary from thinker to thinker but, broadly speaking, reduce to three: if a belief is self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible, it is a proper candidate for inclusion among the foundations of rational belief.

What sorts of beliefs are self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible? A self-evident belief is one that, upon understanding it, you see it to be true. While this definition is probably not self-evident, let’s proceed to understand it by way of example. Read the following fairly quickly:

(4) When equals are added to equals you get equals.

Do you think (4) is true? False? Not sure? Let me explain it. When equals (2 and 1+1) are added to equals (2 and 1+1) you get equals (4). Or, to make this clear 2 + 2 = 1 + 1 + 1 + 1. Now that you understand (4), you see it to be true. I didn’t argue for (4), I simply helped you to understand it, and upon understanding it, you saw it to be true. That is, (4) is self-evident. Typical self-evident beliefs include the laws of logic and arithmetic and some metaphysical principles like “An object can’t be red all over and blue all over at the same time.” A proposition is evident to the senses in case it is properly acquired by the use of one’s five senses. These sorts of propositions include “The grass is green,” “The sky is blue,” “Honey tastes sweet,” and “I hear a mourning dove.” Some epistemologists exclude propositions that are evident to the senses from the foundations of knowledge because of their lack of certainty [the sky may be colorless as a piece of glass but simply refracts blue light waves; we may be sampling artificial (and not real) honey; or someone may be blowing a bird whistle; etc.]. In order to ensure certainty, some have shifted to incorrigibility as the criterion of foundational beliefs. Incorrigible beliefs are first-person psychological states (seeming or appearance beliefs) about which I cannot be wrong. For example, I might be mistaken about the color of the grass or sky but I cannot be mistaken about the following: “The grass seems green to me” or “The sky appears to me to be blue.” I might be mistaken about the color of grass, and so such a belief is not certain for me, but I can’t be wrong about what the color of grass seems to be to me.

Now let us return to belief in God. Why do evidentialists hold (1), the claim that rational belief in God requires the support of evidence or argument? This is typically because they subscribe to classical foundationalism. A belief can be held without argument or evidence only if it is self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible. Belief in God is not self-evident—it is not such that upon understanding the notion of God, you see that God exists. For example, Bertrand Russell understands the proposition “God exists” but does not see it to be true. So, belief in God is not a good candidate for self-evidence. Belief in God is not evident to the senses because God, by definition, transcends the sensory world. God cannot be seen, heard, touched, tasted or smelled. When people make claims such as “God spoke to me” or “I touched God,” they are using “spoke” and “touched” in a metaphorical sense, not a literal sense; literally, God is beyond the senses. So God’s existence is not evident to the senses. And finally, a person might be wrong about God’s existence and so belief in God cannot be incorrigible. Of course, “it seems to me that God exists” could be incorrigible but God’s seeming existence is a long way from God’s existence!

So, belief in God is neither self-evident, evident to the senses, nor incorrigible. Therefore, belief in God, according to classical foundationalism, cannot properly be included among the foundations of one’s rational beliefs. And, if it is not part of the foundations, it must be adequately supported by the foundational beliefs—that is, belief in God must be held on the basis of other beliefs and so must be argued to, not from. According to classical foundationalism, belief in God is not rational unless it is supported by evidence or argument. Classical foundationalism, as assumed in the Enlightenment, elevated theistic arguments to a status never held before in the history of Western thought. Although previous thinkers would develop theistic arguments, they seldom assumed that they were necessary for rational belief in God. After the period of the Enlightenment, thinkers in the grips of classical foundationalism would now hold belief in God up to the demand of rigorous proof.

3. The Reasonableness of Belief in God

There are two main strategies theists employ when responding to the evidentialist objection to belief in God. The first strategy is to argue against the second premise, the claim that there is insufficient evidence for the existence of God. The second strategy is to argue against the first premise, the claim that belief in God is rational only if it is supported by sufficient evidence.

a. Theistic Evidentialism

Consider first the claim that there is not sufficient evidence for the existence of God. This view has been historically rejected by Aristotle, Augustine, Anselm, Thomas Aquinas, John Duns Scotus, John Locke, William Paley and C. S. Peirce, to name but a few. But suppose we all agreed that the arguments offered by Aristotle and others for the existence of God were badly flawed. (“We know better now.”) Does that imply that earlier theists were irrational? Does the evidence have to support, in some timeless way—irrespective of any particular person—belief in God? Aristotle, Augustine, Aquinas, et al., were brilliant people doing the best they could with the most sophisticated belief-set available to them and judged, on the basis of their best lights, that the evidence supported belief in God. Are they nonetheless irrational? For example, suppose that, ignorant of the principle of inertia, Aquinas believed that God must be actively involved in the continual motion of the planets. That is, suppose that, using the best physics of his day, Aquinas believed in the scientific necessity of belief in God. According to his best lights, Aquinas thought that the evidence clearly supported belief in God. Would Aquinas be irrational? Evidentialist objectors might concede that Aquinas was not irrational, in spite of his bad arguments and, therefore, might not view rationality as being timeless. But, they would argue, it is no longer reasonable for anyone to believe in God because now we all see or should see that the evidence is clearly insufficient to support the conclusion that God exists. (This ‘we’ tends toward the princely philosophical.)

Some theists reject this conclusion, judging that there is adequate evidence to support God’s existence. Rejecting the idea that theistic arguments died along with Kant and Hume, these thinkers offer new evidence or refashion the old evidence for the existence of God. William Lane Craig (Craig and Smith 1993), for example, has developed a new version of the old Islamic Kalaam cosmological argument for the existence of God. This argument attempts to demonstrate the impossibility that time could have proceeded infinitely into the past so the universe must have had a beginning in time. In addition, both physicists and philosophers have argued that the apparent fine-tuning of the cosmological constants to permit human life is best explained by God’s intelligent superintendence. And some argue that irreducibly complex biological phenomena such as cells or kidneys could not have arisen by chance. Robert Merrihew Adams (1987) has revived moral arguments for the existence of God. Alvin Plantinga (1993b) has argued that naturalism and evolution are self-refuting. William Alston (1991) has defended religious experience as a source of justified belief in the existence of God. In addition, theistic arguments have been developed that are based on the existence of flavors, colors and beauty. And some thinkers, such as Richard Swinburne (1979, 1984), contend that the cumulative forces of these various kinds of evidence mutually reinforce the likelihood of God’s existence. Thus, there is an ample lot defending the claim that belief in God is rational based on the evidence (and an equal and opposite force opposing them). So the project of securing belief in God on the basis of evidence or argument is ongoing.

Many theists, then, concur with the evidentialist demand for evidence and seek to meet that demand by offering arguments that support the existence of God. Of course, these arguments have been widely criticized by atheistic evidentialists. But for better or for worse, many theistic philosophers have hitched the rationality of belief in God to the wagon of evidence.

Now suppose, as is the case, that the majority of philosophers believes that these attempts to prove God’s existence are feeble failures. Would that perforce make religious believers irrational? If one, by the best of one’s lights, judges that God exists given the carefully considered evidence, is one nonetheless irrational if the majority of the philosophical community happen to disagree? These questions suggest that judgments of rationality and irrationality are difficult to make. And, it suggests that rationality and irrationality may be more complicated than classical foundationalism assumes.

b. Sociological Digression

Very few philosophical positions (and this is an understatement) enjoy the kind of evidential support that classical foundationalism demands of belief in God; yet most of these are treated as rational. No philosophical position—belief in other minds, belief in the external world, the correspondence theory of truth or Quine’s indeterminacy of translation thesis—is properly based on beliefs that are self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible. Indeed, we may question whether there is a single philosophical position that has been so amply justified (or could be). Why is belief in God held to a higher evidential standard than other philosophical beliefs? Some suggest that this demand is simply arbitrary at best or intellectually imperialist at worst.

c. Moral Analogy

Consider your moral beliefs. None of these beliefs will be self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible. Now suppose you hold a moral belief that is not the philosophical fashion these days. Would you be irrational if the majority of contemporary philosophers disagreed with you? Perhaps you’d be irrational if moral beliefs contrary to yours could be established on the basis of widely known arguments from premises that are self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible. But there may be no such arguments in the history of moral theory. Moral beliefs are not well-justified on the basis of argument or evidence in the classical foundationalist sense (or probably in any sense of “well-justified”). So, the fact that the majority of contemporary philosophers reject your moral beliefs (or belief in God for that matter) may have little or no bearing on the rationality of your beliefs. The sociological digression and moral analogy suggest that the philosophical emphasis on argument, certainty, and consensus for rationality might be misguided.

d. Reformed Epistemology

Let us now turn to those who reject the first premise of the evidentialist objection to belief in God, the claim that rational belief in God requires the support of evidence or argument. Recent thinkers such as Alvin Plantinga, Nicholas Wolterstorff and William Alston, in their so called Reformed Epistemology, have argued that belief in God does not require the support of evidence or argument in order for it to be rational (cf. Plantinga and Wolterstorff 1983). In so doing, they reject the evidentialist objector’s assumptions about rationality.

Reformed epistemologists argue that the first problem with the evidentialist objection is that the universal demand for evidence simply cannot be met in a large number of cases with the cognitive equipment that we have. No one has ever been able to offer proofs for the existence of other persons, inductive beliefs (e.g., that the sun will rise in the future), or the reality of the past (perhaps, as Bertrand Russell cloyingly puzzled, we were created five minutes ago with our memories intact) that satisfy classical foundationalist requirements for proof. So, according to classical foundationalism, belief in the past and inductive beliefs about the future are irrational. This list could be extended indefinitely.

There is also a limit to the things that human beings can prove. If we were required to prove everything, there would be an infinite regress of provings. There must be some truths that we can just accept and reason from. Thus, we can’t help but trust our cognitive faculties. Moreover, it seems that we will reach the limit of proof very quickly if, as classical foundationalism insists, the basis for inference includes only beliefs that are self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible. For these reasons, reformed epistemologists doubt that classical foundationalists are correct in claiming that the proper starting point of reason is self-evidence, evidence to the senses, and incorrigibility.

A second criticism of classical foundationalism, first offered by Plantinga, is that it is self-referentially inconsistent. That is, classical foundationalism must be rejected by its own account. Recall classical foundationalism (CF):

A proposition p is rational if and only if p is self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible or if p can be inferred from a set of propositions that are self-evident, evident to the senses, or incorrigible.

Consider CF itself. Is it rational, given its own conditions, to accept classical foundationalism? Classical foundationalism is not self-evident: upon understanding it many people believe it false. If one can understand a proposition and reject it, that proposition cannot be self-evident. CF is also not a sensory proposition—one doesn’t see, taste, smell, touch or hear it. So, classical foundationalism is not evident to the senses. And even if one should accept classical foundationalism, one might be wrong; so classical foundationalism is not incorrigible. Since classical foundationalism is neither self-evident, evident to the senses nor incorrigible, it can only be rationally maintained if it can be inferred from propositions that (ultimately) are self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible. Is that possible? Consider a representative set of evidential propositions, E, that are self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible:

Evidence (E):

When equals are added to equals you get equals.

2 + 2 = 4

Grass is green.

The sky is blue.

Grass seems green to me.

The sky appears to me to be blue.

Limiting yourself to propositions that are self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible, you can expand this list as exhaustively as you like. We have enough in E to make our case. Given E as evidence, can CF be inferred? Is E adequate evidence for CF? It’s hard to imagine how it could be. Indeed all of the propositions in E are irrelevant to the truth of CF. E simply cannot logically support CF. So, CF is not self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible, nor can CF be inferred from a set of propositions that are self-evident, evident to the senses or incorrigible. So, CF, by its own account, is irrational. If CF were true, it would be irrational to accept it. Better simply to reject it!

Thomas Reid (1710-1796), whom Plantinga and Wolterstorff follow, was an early critic of classical foundationalism. Reid argued that we have been outfitted with a host of cognitive faculties that produce beliefs that we can reason from (the foundations of believings). Plantinga calls these basic beliefs. The kinds of beliefs that we do and must reason to is a small subset of the kinds of beliefs that we do and must reason from. The latter must be accepted without the aid of proof. In most cases we must rely on our intellectual equipment to produce beliefs in the appropriate circumstances, without evidence or argument. For example, we simply find ourselves believing in other persons. A person is a center of self-conscious thoughts and feelings and first-person experience. While we can see a human face or a body, we can’t see another’s thoughts or feelings. Consider a person, Emily, whose leg is poked with a needle. We can see Emily recoil and her face screw up, and we can hear her yelp. So we can see Emily’s pain-behavior, but we cannot see her pain. The experience of pain is just the sort of inner experience that is typical of persons. For all we can know from Emily’s pain-behavior, she might be a cleverly constructed automaton (like Data of Star Trek fame or an exact human replica all the way down to the neurons). Or, for all we know, Emily might be a person just like us with the characteristic interior life and experience of persons. The point is, you can’t tell, just from Emily’s pain behavior, if she has any inner experience of pain. So you can’t tell by the things to which you have evidential access if Emily is a person. No one has ever been able to develop a successful argument to prove that there are other persons. So if classical foundationalism were true, it would not be reasonable to believe in the existence of other persons. But surely there are other persons whose existence it is reasonable to accept. So much the worse for classical foundationalism, Reidians say. Similar problems arise for classical foundationalism concerning beliefs in the past, the future, and the external world. No justification-conferring inference is or could be involved. Yet, the Reidian claims, we are perfectly within our epistemic rights in holding these basic beliefs. Thus, we should conclude that these beliefs are properly basic (that is, non-inferential but justified beliefs) and should reject classical foundationalism’s claim to the contrary.

Granting that a great many of our important beliefs are non-inferential, could one reasonably find oneself believing in God without evidence or argument? ‘Evidence’ is to be understood here as most evidentialists understand it, namely as the kind of propositional evidence one might find in a theistic argument and not the kind of experiential evidence typically thought to ground religious belief. Could belief in God be properly basic?

There are at least two reasons to believe that it might be rational for a person to accept belief in God without the support of an argument. The first is a parity argument. We must, by our nature, accept the deliverances of our cognitive faculties, including those that produce beliefs in the external world, other persons, that the future will be like the past, the reality of the past, and what other people tell us—just to name a few. For the sake of parity, we should trust the deliverances of the faculty that produces in us belief in the divine (what Plantinga (2000), following John Calvin, calls the sensus divinitatus, the sense of the divine). Of course, some philosophers deny that we have a sensus divinitatus and so reject the parity argument. The second reason is that belief in God is more like belief in a person than belief in a scientific hypothesis. Human relations demand trust, commitment, and faith. If belief in God is more like belief in other persons than belief in atoms, then the trust that is appropriate to persons will be appropriate to God. William James offers a similar argument in “The Will to Believe.”

Reformed epistemologists hold that one can reasonably believe in God—immediately and basically—without the support of an argument. One’s properly functioning cognitive faculties can produce belief in God in the appropriate circumstances with or without argument or evidence.

e. Religious Experience

Although Plantinga contends that belief in God does not require the support of propositional evidence or argument (like a theistic proof) in order to be rational, he does contend that belief in God is not groundless. According to Plantinga, belief in God is grounded in characteristic religious experiences such as beholding the divine majesty on the top of a mountain or the divine creativity when noticing the articulate beauty of the flower. Other sorts of alleged religious experiences involve a sense of guilt (and forgiveness), despair, the inner testimony of the Holy Spirit, or direct contact with the divine (mysticism). The experience of many believers is so vivid that they describe it with sensory metaphors: they claim to see, hear or be touched by God.

It is important to note that people who believe on the basis of religious experience do not typically construe their belief in God as based on an argument (any more than belief in other persons is based on an argument). They believe they have seen or heard God directly and find themselves overwhelmed by belief in God. Religious experience is typically taken as self-authenticating. In good Reidian fashion, one might simply take it that one has a cognitive faculty that can be trusted when it produces belief in God when induced by the appropriate experiences; that is, one is permitted to trust one’s initial alleged religious experience as veridical, just as one must trust that others of one’s cognitive faculties are veridical. (It should be noted that Reid himself does not make this claim. He believes that God’s existence can and should be supported by argument.) Richard Swinburne alleges that it is also reasonable to trust what others tell us unless and until we have good reason to believe otherwise. So, it would be reasonable for someone who did not have a religious experience to trust the veridicality of someone who did claim to have a religious experience. That is, it would be reasonable for everyone, not just the subject of the alleged religious experience, to believe in God on the basis of that alleged religious experience.

Some philosophers reject religious experience as a proper ground for religious belief. While not denying that some people have had powerful, so-called mystical experiences, they deny that one can reliably infer from that experience that the source or cause of that experience was God. Even the most enthusiastic mystics contend that some mystical experiences are illusory. So, how does one sort out the veridical from the illusory without begging the question? And if other evidence must be brought in to assess the validity of religious experience, is not then religious belief based more on that evidence than on the immediate experience? William Alston (1991) responds to these sorts of challenges by noting that perceptual experience, which is seldom questioned, is afflicted with precisely the same problems. Yet we do not take perceptual beliefs to be suspect. Alston argues that if religious experiences and the beliefs they produce relevantly resemble perceptual experiences and the beliefs they produce, then we should not hold beliefs based upon religious experience to be suspect either.

f. Internalism/Externalism

Some of the most important issues concerning the rationality of religious belief are framed in terms of the distinction between internalism and externalism in epistemology. Philosophers who are internalists with respect to rationality argue that we can tell, from the inside so to speak, if our beliefs are rationally justified. The language used by the classical foundationalist to describe basic beliefs is thoroughly internalist. ‘Self-evident’ and ‘evident to the senses’ are suggestive of beliefs that have a certain inner, compelling and unquestionable luminosity; one can simply inspect one’s beliefs and “see” if they are evident in the appropriate respects. And since deductive inference transfers rational justification from lower levels to higher levels, by carefully checking the inferential relations among one’s beliefs, one can see this luminosity passing from basic to non-basic beliefs. So internalists believe that rationality is something that can be discerned by the mental inspection of one’s own beliefs, items to which one has direct cognitive access.

Plantinga, on the other hand, argues that modern foundationalism has misunderstood the nature of rational justification. Plantinga calls the special property that turns true belief into knowledge “warrant.” According to Plantinga, a belief has warrant for one if and only if that belief is produced by one’s properly functioning cognitive faculties in circumstances to which those faculties are designed to apply; in addition, those faculties must be designed for the purpose of producing true beliefs. So, for instance, my belief that ‘there is a computer screen in front of me’ is warranted only if it is produced by my properly functioning perceptual faculties (and not by weariness or dreaming), if no one is tricking me, say, by having removed my computer and replaced it with an exact painting of my computer (thereby messing up my cognitive environment), and if my perceptual faculties have been designed (by God) for the purpose of producing true beliefs. Only if all of these conditions are satisfied is my belief that there is a computer screen in front of me warranted.

Note the portions of Plantinga’s definition which are not within one’s internal or direct purview: whether or not one’s faculties are functioning properly, whether or not one’s faculties are designed by God, whether or not one’s faculties are designed for the production of true beliefs, whether or not one is using one’s faculties in the environment intended for their use (one might be seeing a mirage and taking it for real). According to Plantinga’s externalism we cannot acquire warrant simply by attending to our beliefs. Warranted belief (knowledge) depends on circumstances external to the believing agent and so is not entirely up to us. Warrant depends crucially upon whether or not conditions that are not under our direct rational purview or conscious control are satisfied. If externalism is correct, then classical foundationalism has completely misunderstood the nature of epistemic warrant.

g. The Rational Stance

Because of the possibility of error, those who accept belief in God as a basic belief should nonetheless be concerned with evidence for and against belief in God. Following Reid, Reformed epistemologists contend that belief begins with trust (not suspicion, as the evidentialist apparently claims). Beliefs are, in their terms, innocent until proven guilty rather than guilty until proven innocent. In order to grasp reality, we must use and trust our cognitive faculties or capacities. But we also know that we get things wrong. The deliverances of our cognitive faculties are not infallible. Reid, Plantinga and Wolterstorff are keenly aware of human fallibility and recognize the need for a deliberative (reasoning) faculty that helps us adjudicate apparent conflicts among beliefs delivered innocently by our cognitive faculties. Reid’s general approach to rational belief is this: trust the beliefs produced by your cognitive faculties in the appropriate circumstances, unless you have good reason to reject them.

Let’s press the problem of error. As shown by widespread disagreement, our cognitive faculties seem less reliable in matters of fundamental human concern such as the nature of morality, the nature of persons, social and political thought, and belief in God. Given that rationality is truth-aimed, Reformed epistemologists should be willing to do two things to make the attainment of that goal more likely. First, they ought to seek, as best they can, supporting evidence for immediately produced beliefs of fundamental human concern. Because evidence is truth-conducive, it can lend credence to a basic belief. It doesn’t follow that basic beliefs about morality, God, etc. are irrational until such evidence is adduced; but perhaps one’s epistemic status on these matters can be improved by obtaining confirming evidence. This would make Reformed epistemology a paradigmatic example of the Augustinian view of faith and reason: fides quaerens intellectum (faith seeking understanding). Second, they ought to be open to contrary evidence to root out false beliefs. Given the likelihood that they could be wrong about these matters, they ought not close themselves off to the possibility of epistemic correction. If Reformed epistemologists are sincere truth-seekers, they should take the following stance:

The Rational Stance: Trust the deliverances of reason, seek supporting evidence, and be open to contrary evidence.

According to Reformed epistemology, evidence may not be required for belief in God to be rational. But, given the problem of error, it should nonetheless continue to play an important role in the life of the believer. Fides quaerens intellectum.

h. Objections to Reformed Epistemology

Reformed epistemology has been rejected for three primary reasons. First, some philosophers deny that we have a sensus divinitatus and so reject the parity argument. Second, some philosophers argue that Reformed epistemology is too latitudinarian, permitting the rational acceptability of virtually any belief. Gary Gutting calls this ‘the Great Pumpkin Objection’ because Charlie Brown could have written a defense of the sensus pumpkinus that is parallel to Plantinga’s defense of the sensus divinitatus. Finally, Reformed epistemology has been rejected because it has been perceived to be a form of fideism. Fideism is the view that belief in God should be held in the absence of or even in opposition to reason. According to this traditional definition of fideism, Reformed epistemology does not count as a form of fideism because it goes to great lengths to show that belief in God is rational. However, if one defines fideism as the view that belief in God may be rightly held in the absence of evidence or argument, then Reformed epistemology will be a kind of fideism.

4. Groundless Believing

With their emphasis on reason, very few philosophers aspire to fideism. Nonetheless, some major thinkers have denied that reason plays any significant role in the life of the religious believer. Tertullian’s rhetorical question, “What has Jerusalem to do with Athens?”, is meant to elicit the view that faith (the Jerusalem of Jesus) has little or nothing to do with reason (the Athens of Socrates, Plato and Aristotle). Tertullian would go on to say, “I believe because it’s absurd.” Pascal (1623-1662), Kierkegaard (1813-1855) and followers of Wittgenstein (late 20th C.) have all been accused of fideism (which is the philosophical equivalent of calling a US citizen a “commie” in the 1950s). Let us consider their positions.

Pascal’s wager brings costs and benefits into the analysis of the rationality of religious belief. Given the possibility that God exists and that the unbeliever will be punished with eternal damnation and the believer rewarded with eternal bliss, Pascal argues that it is rational to wager that God exists. Using a rational, prudential decision procedure he asks us to consider placing a bet on God’s existence. If one bets on God, then either God exists and one enjoys an eternity of bliss or God does not exist and one loses very little. On the other hand, if one bets against God and wins, one gains very little, but if one loses that bet, then the one will suffer in hell forever. Prudence demands that one should believe in God’s existence. Pascal concludes: “Wager, then, that God exists.”

Pascal’s wager has been widely criticized, but we shall only consider here the relevance of the wager to Pascal’s view of faith and reason. The wager is just one of his many tools for shocking people into caring about their eternal destinies. After arguing that our desires affect our abilities to discern the truth, he tries to get our desires appropriately oriented toward the truth. The wager can stimulate the desire to seek the truth about God and, after one’s desires are changed, the ability to judge the evidences for Christianity properly. So, in spite of the prominence of the wager and its apparent disregard for evidence, Pascal appears to be a kind of evidentialist after all (but not a classical foundationalist).

Søren Kierkegaard’s emphasis on the role of inwardness or subjective appropriation has played a role in his being understood as a fideist. His reaction against both rationalism and dogmatism led him to view faith as a certain madness, a “leap” one makes beyond what is reasonable (a leap into the absurd). Some philosophers argue that Kierkegaard is simply emphasizing that faith is more than rational assent to the truth of a proposition, involving more fundamentally the passionate commitment of the heart.

Finally, followers of the enigmatic Ludwig Wittgenstein have defended the groundlessness of belief in God, a view that has been called “Wittgensteinian fideism.” Wittgenstein’s later works both noticed and affirmed the tremendous variety of our beliefs that are not held because of reasons—such beliefs are, according to Wittgenstein, groundless. Many of Wittgenstein’s most prominent students are religious believers, some of whom took his general insights into the structure of human belief and applied them to religious belief. Norman Malcolm, for example, favorably compares belief in God to the belief that things don’t vanish into thin air. Both are part of the untested and untestable framework of human belief. These frameworks form the system of beliefs within which testing of other beliefs can take place. While we can justify beliefs within the framework, we cannot justify the framework itself. The giving of reasons must come to an end. And then we believe, groundlessly.

5. Conclusion

In Western European countries, religious belief has waned since the time of the Enlightenment. Yet there are counter trends. Today over 90% of Americans profess belief in a higher power. In China, after decades of institutionally enforced atheism, religious belief is dramatically on the rise. And even though religious belief has waned among professional Anglo-American philosophers since the Enlightenment, many prominent Anglo-American philosophers are theists. What conclusions can be drawn from these sociological observations? That Reason will eventually triumph over superstition as all countries eventually follow Western Europe’s lead? That irrational religious belief is so stubbornly tenacious that Reason is incapable of wiping it out? That the natural tendency to believe in God is overlaid by various forms of sin (such as greed in the West or wicked Communism in the East)? That once the evidence is made clear to a deprived peoples, rational belief in God will flourish? Of course, these sociological facts are irrelevant to discussions of rational belief in God. Yet they are relevant to this: the persistence of religious belief in various contexts will continue to spur discussions of and developments in the epistemology of the religious for succeeding generations.

See also the article “Religious Disagreement.”

6. References and Further Reading

Adams, Robert Merrihew. The Virtue of Faith and Other Essays. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1987.
Adams, Marilyn McCord and Robert Merrihew Adams, eds. The Problem of Evil. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1990.
Alston, William. Perceiving God. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1991.
Brockelman, Paul T. Cosmology and Creation: The Spiritual Significance of Contemporary Cosmology. New York: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Clark, Kelly James. Return to Reason: A Critique of Enlightenment Evidentialism and a Defense of Reason and Belief in God. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1990.
Craig, William Lane, and Quentin Smith. Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1993.
Davis, Stephen. God, Reason and Theistic Proofs. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1997.
Gutting, Gary. Religious Belief and Religious Skepticism. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1982.
Helm, Paul. Faith and Understanding. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1997.
Hume, David. Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. New York: Routledge, 1779/1991.
Huxley, T. H. Agnosticism and Christianity, and Other Essays. Buffalo, NY: Prometheus Books, 1931/1992.
Jordan, Jeff, ed. Gambling on God, Lanham MD: Rowman & Littlefield, 1994.
Le Poidevin, Robin. Arguing for Atheism: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion. New York: Routledge, 1996.
Murray, Michael, ed. Reason for the Hope Within. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1999.
Plantinga, Alvin, and Nicholas Wolterstorff, eds. Faith and Rationality: Reason and Belief in God. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1983.
Plantinga, Alvin.. Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press, 1993.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press, 1993.
Russell, Bertrand. Why I Am Not a Christian, and Other Essays on Religion and Related Subjects. New York: Simon and Schuster, 1957. Swinburne, Richard. The Existence of God. New York: Clarendon Press, 1979.
Swinburne, Richard. Faith and Reason. New York: Oxford University Press, 1984.
Wainwright, William. Reason and the Heart: A Prolegomenon to a Critique of Passional Reason. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1995.Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Reason within the Bounds of Religion. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1976.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. Thomas Reid and the Story of Epistemology. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Zagzebski, Linda, ed. Rational Faith: Catholic Responses to Reformed Epistemology. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1993.

Author Information

Kelly James Clark
Email: kclark@calvin.edu
Calvin College
U. S. A.

Truth

Philosophers are interested in a constellation of issues involving the concept of truth. A preliminary issue, although somewhat subsidiary, is to decide what sorts of things can be true. Is truth a property of sentences (which are linguistic entities in some language or other), or is truth a property of propositions (nonlinguistic, abstract and timeless entities)? The principal issue is: What is truth? It is the problem of being clear about what you are saying when you say some claim or other is true. The most important theories of truth are the Correspondence Theory, the Semantic Theory, the Deflationary Theory, the Coherence Theory, and the Pragmatic Theory. They are explained and compared here. Whichever theory of truth is advanced to settle the principal issue, there are a number of additional issues to be addressed:

Can claims about the future be true now?
Can there be some algorithm for finding truth – some recipe or procedure for deciding, for any claim in the system of, say, arithmetic, whether the claim is true?
Can the predicate “is true” be completely defined in other terms so that it can be eliminated, without loss of meaning, from any context in which it occurs?
To what extent do theories of truth avoid paradox?
Is the goal of scientific research to achieve truth?

The Principal Problem
What Sorts of Things are True (or False)?
Correspondence Theory
Tarski’s Semantic Theory
Coherence Theories
1. Postmodernism: The Most Recent Coherence Theory
Pragmatic Theories
Deflationary Theories
Related Issues
References and Further Reading

1. The Principal Problem

The principal problem is to offer a viable theory as to what truth itself consists in, or, to put it another way, “What is the nature of truth?” To illustrate with an example – the problem is not: Is it true that there is extraterrestrial life? The problem is: What does it mean to say that it is true that there is extraterrestrial life? Astrobiologists study the former problem; philosophers, the latter.

This philosophical problem of truth has been with us for a long time. In the first century AD, Pontius Pilate (John 18:38) asked “What is truth?” but no answer was forthcoming. The problem has been studied more since the turn of the twentieth century than at any other previous time. In the last one hundred or so years, considerable progress has been made in solving the problem.

The three most widely accepted contemporary theories of truth are [i] the Correspondence Theory ; [ii] the Semantic Theory of Tarski and Davidson; and [iii] the Deflationary Theory of Frege and Ramsey. The competing theories are [iv] the Coherence Theory , and [v] the Pragmatic Theory . These five theories will be examined after addressing the following question.

2. What Sorts of Things are True (or False)?

Although we do speak of true friends and false identities, philosophers believe these are derivative uses of “true” and “false”. The central use of “true”, the more important one for philosophers, occurs when we say, for example, it’s true that Montreal is north of Pittsburgh. Here,”true” is contrasted with “false”, not with “fake” or “insincere”. When we say that Montreal is north of Pittsburgh, what sort of thing is it that is true? Is it a statement or a sentence or something else, a “fact”, perhaps? More generally, philosophers want to know what sorts of things are true and what sorts of things are false. This same question is expressed by asking: What sorts of things have (or bear) truth-values?

The term “truth-value” has been coined by logicians as a generic term for “truth or falsehood”. To ask for the truth-value of P, is to ask whether P is true or whether P is false. “Value” in “truth-value” does not mean “valuable”. It is being used in a similar fashion to “numerical value” as when we say that the value of “x” in “x + 3 = 7” is 4. To ask “What is the truth-value of the statement that Montreal is north of Pittsburgh?” is to ask whether the statement that Montreal is north of Pittsburgh is true or whether it is false. (The truth-value of that specific statement is true.)

There are many candidates for the sorts of things that can bear truth-values:

statements
sentence-tokens
sentence-types
propositions
theories
facts

assertions
utterances
beliefs
opinions
doctrines
etc.

a. Ontological Issues

What sorts of things are these candidates? In particular, should the bearers of truth-values be regarded as being linguistic items (and, as a consequence, items within specific languages), or are they non-linguistic items, or are they both? In addition, should they be regarded as being concrete entities, i.e., things which have a determinate position in space and time, or should they be regarded as abstract entities, i.e., as being neither temporal nor spatial entities?

Sentences are linguistic items: they exist in some language or other, either in a natural language such as English or in an artificial language such as a computer language. However, the term “sentence” has two senses: sentence-token and sentence-type. These three English sentence-tokens are all of the same sentence-type:

Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun.
Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun.
Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun.

Sentence-tokens are concrete objects. They are composed of ink marks on paper, or sequences of sounds, or patches of light on a computer monitor, etc. Sentence-tokens exist in space and time; they can be located in space and can be dated. Sentence-types cannot be. They are abstract objects. (Analogous distinctions can be made for letters, for words, for numerals, for musical notes on a stave, indeed for any symbols whatsoever.)

Might sentence-tokens be the bearers of truth-values?

One reason to favor tokens over types is to solve the problems involving so-called “indexical” (or “token reflexive”) terms such as “I” and “here” and “now”. Is the claim expressed by the sentence-type “I like chocolate” true or false? Well, it depends on who “I” is referring to. If Jack, who likes chocolate, says “I like chocolate”, then what he has said is true; but if Jill, who dislikes chocolate, says “I like chocolate”, then what she has said is false. If it were sentence-types which were the bearers of truth-values, then the sentence-type “I like chocolate” would be both true and false – an unacceptable contradiction. The contradiction is avoided, however, if one argues that sentence-tokens are the bearers of truth-values, for in this case although there is only one sentence-type involved, there are two distinct sentence-tokens.

A second reason for arguing that sentence-tokens, rather than sentence-types, are the bearers of truth-values has been advanced by nominalist philosophers. Nominalists are intent to allow as few abstract objects as possible. Insofar as sentence-types are abstract objects and sentence-tokens are concrete objects, nominalists will argue that actually uttered or written sentence-tokens are the proper bearers of truth-values.

But the theory that sentence-tokens are the bearers of truth-values has its own problems. One objection to the nominalist theory is that had there never been any language-users, then there would be no truths. (And the same objection can be leveled against arguing that it is beliefs that are the bearers of truth-values: had there never been any conscious creatures then there would be no beliefs and, thus, no truths or falsehoods, not even the truth that there were no conscious creatures – an unacceptably paradoxical implication.)

And a second objection – to the theory that sentence-tokens are the bearers of truth-values – is that even though there are language-users, there are sentences that have never been uttered and never will be. (Consider, for example, the distinct number of different ways that a deck of playing cards can be arranged. The number, 8×10⁶⁷ [the digit “8” followed by sixty-seven zeros], is so vast that there never will be enough sentence-tokens in the world’s past or future to describe each unique arrangement. And there are countless other examples as well.) Sentence-tokens, then, cannot be identified as the bearers of truth-values – there simply are too few sentence-tokens.

Thus both theories – (i) that sentence-tokens are the bearers of truth-values, and (ii) that sentence-types are the bearers of truth-values – encounter difficulties. Might propositions be the bearers of truth-values?

To escape the dilemma of choosing between tokens and types, propositions have been suggested as the primary bearers of truth-values.

The following five sentences are in different languages, but they all are typically used to express the same proposition or statement.

Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun. [English]

Saturn je šestá planeta od slunce. [Czech]

Saturne est la sixième planète la plus éloignée du soleil. [French]

[Hebrew]

Saturn er den sjette planeten fra solen. [Norwegian]

The truth of the proposition that Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun depends only on the physics of the solar system, and not in any obvious way on human convention. By contrast, what these five sentences say does depend partly on human convention. Had English speakers chosen to adopt the word “Saturn” as the name of a different particular planet, the first sentence would have expressed something false. By choosing propositions rather than sentences as the bearers of truth-values, this relativity to human conventions does not apply to truth, a point that many philosophers would consider to be a virtue in a theory of truth.

Propositions are abstract entities; they do not exist in space and time. They are sometimes said to be “timeless”, “eternal”, or “omnitemporal” entities. Terminology aside, the essential point is that propositions are not concrete (or material) objects. Nor, for that matter, are they mental entities; they are not “thoughts” as Frege had suggested in the nineteenth century. The theory that propositions are the bearers of truth-values also has been criticized. Nominalists object to the abstract character of propositions. Another complaint is that it’s not sufficiently clear when we have a case of the same propositions as opposed to similar propositions. This is much like the complaint that we can’t determine when two sentences have exactly the same meaning. The relationship between sentences and propositions is a serious philosophical problem.

Because it is the more favored theory, and for the sake of expediency and consistency, the theory that propositions – and not sentences – are the bearers of truth-values will be adopted in this article. When we speak below of “truths”, we are referring to true propositions. But it should be pointed out that virtually all the claims made below have counterparts in nominalistic theories which reject propositions.

b. Constraints on Truth and Falsehood

There are two commonly accepted constraints on truth and falsehood:

Every proposition is true or false. [Law of the Excluded Middle.]

No proposition is both true and false. [Law of Non-contradiction.]

These constraints require that every proposition has exactly one truth-value. Although the point is controversial, most philosophers add the further constraint that a proposition never changes its truth-value in space or time. Consequently, to say “The proposition that it’s raining was true yesterday but false today” is to equivocate and not actually refer to just one proposition. Similarly, when someone at noon on January 15, 2000 in Vancouver says that the proposition that it is raining is true in Vancouver while false in Sacramento, that person is really talking of two different propositions: (i) that it rains in Vancouver at noon on January 15, 2000 and (ii) that it rains in Sacramento at noon on January 15, 2000. The person is saying proposition (i) is true and (ii) is false.

c. Which Sentences Express Propositions?

Not all sentences express propositions. The interrogative sentence “Who won the World Series in 1951?” does not; neither does the imperative sentence “Please close the window.” Declarative (that is, indicative) sentences – rather than interrogative or imperative sentences – typically are used to express propositions.

d. Problem Cases

But do all declarative sentences express propositions? The following four kinds of declarative sentences have been suggested as not being typically used to express propositions, but all these suggestions are controversial.

1. Sentences containing non-referring expressions

In light of the fact that France has no king, Strawson argued that the sentence, “The present king of France is bald”, fails to express a proposition. In a famous dispute, Russell disagreed with Strawson, arguing that the sentence does express a proposition, and more exactly, a false one.

2. Predictions of future events

What about declarative sentences that refer to events in the future? For example, does the sentence “There will be a sea battle tomorrow” express a proposition? Presumably, today we do not know whether there will be such a battle. Because of this, some philosophers (including Aristotle who toyed with the idea) have argued that the sentence, at the present moment, does not express anything that is now either true or false. Another, perhaps more powerful, motivation for adopting this view is the belief that if sentences involving future human actions were to express propositions, i.e., were to express something that is now true or false, then humans would be determined to perform those actions and so humans would have no free will. To defend free will, these philosophers have argued, we must deny truth-values to predictions.

This complicating restriction – that sentences about the future do not now express anything true or false – has been attacked by Quine and others. These critics argue that the restriction upsets the logic we use to reason with such predictions. For example, here is a deductively valid argument involving predictions:

We’ve learned there will be a run on the bank tomorrow.
If there will be a run on the bank tomorrow, then the CEO should be awakened.

So, the CEO should be awakened.

Without assertions in this argument having truth-values, regardless of whether we know those values, we could not assess the argument using the canons of deductive validity and invalidity. We would have to say – contrary to deeply-rooted philosophical intuitions – that it is not really an argument at all. (For another sort of rebuttal to the claim that propositions about the future cannot be true prior to the occurrence of the events described, see Logical Determinism.)

3. Liar Sentences

“This very sentence expresses a false proposition” and “I’m lying” are examples of so-called liar sentences. A liar sentence can be used to generate a paradox when we consider what truth-value to assign it. As a way out of paradox, Kripke suggests that a liar sentence is one of those rare declarative sentences that does not express a proposition. The sentence falls into the truth-value gap. See the article Liar Paradox.

4. Sentences that state moral, ethical, or aesthetic values

Finally, we mention the so-called “fact/value distinction.” Throughout history, moral philosophers have wrestled with the issue of moral realism. Do sentences such as “Torturing children is wrong” – which assert moral principles – assert something true (or false), or do they merely express (in a disguised fashion) the speaker’s opinions, or feelings or values? Making the latter choice, some philosophers argue that these declarative sentences do not express propositions.

3. Correspondence Theory

We return to the principal question, “What is truth?” Truth is presumably what valid reasoning preserves. It is the goal of scientific inquiry, historical research, and business audits. We understand much of what a sentence means by understanding the conditions under which what it expresses is true. Yet the exact nature of truth itself is not wholly revealed by these remarks.

Historically, the most popular theory of truth was the Correspondence Theory. First proposed in a vague form by Plato and by Aristotle in his Metaphysics, this realist theory says truth is what propositions have by corresponding to a way the world is. The theory says that a proposition is true provided there exists a fact corresponding to it. In other words, for any proposition p,

p is true if and only if p corresponds to a fact.

The theory’s answer to the question, “What is truth?” is that truth is a certain relationship—the relationship that holds between a proposition and its corresponding fact. Perhaps an analysis of the relationship will reveal what all the truths have in common.

Consider the proposition that snow is white. Remarking that the proposition’s truth is its corresponding to the fact that snow is white leads critics to request an acceptable analysis of this notion of correspondence. Surely the correspondence is not a word by word connecting of a sentence to its reference. It is some sort of exotic relationship between, say, whole propositions and facts. In presenting his theory of logical atomism early in the twentieth century, Russell tried to show how a true proposition and its corresponding fact share the same structure. Inspired by the notion that Egyptian hieroglyphs are stylized pictures, his student Wittgenstein said the relationship is that of a “picturing” of facts by propositions, but his development of this suggestive remark in his Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus did not satisfy many other philosophers, nor after awhile, even Wittgenstein himself.

And what are facts? The notion of a fact as some sort of ontological entity was first stated explicitly in the second half of the nineteenth century. The Correspondence Theory does permit facts to be mind-dependent entities. McTaggart, and perhaps Kant, held such Correspondence Theories. The Correspondence theories of Russell, Wittgenstein and Austin all consider facts to be mind-independent. But regardless of their mind-dependence or mind-independence, the theory must provide answers to questions of the following sort. “Canada is north of the U.S.” can’t be a fact. A true proposition can’t be a fact if it also states a fact, so what is the ontological standing of a fact? Is the fact that corresponds to “Brutus stabbed Caesar” the same fact that corresponds to “Caesar was stabbed by Brutus”, or is it a different fact? It might be argued that they must be different facts because one expresses the relationship of stabbing but the other expresses the relationship of being stabbed, which is different. In addition to the specific fact that ball 1 is on the pool table and the specific fact that ball 2 is on the pool table, and so forth, is there the specific fact that there are fewer than 1,006,455 balls on the table? Is there the general fact that many balls are on the table? Does the existence of general facts require there to be the Forms of Plato or Aristotle? What about the negative proposition that there are no pink elephants on the table? Does it correspond to the same situation in the world that makes there be no green elephants on the table? The same pool table must involve a great many different facts. These questions illustrate the difficulty in counting facts and distinguishing them. The difficulty is well recognized by advocates of the Correspondence Theory, but critics complain that characterizations of facts too often circle back ultimately to saying facts are whatever true propositions must correspond to in order to be true. Davidson has criticized the notion of fact, arguing that “if true statements correspond to anything, they all correspond to the same thing” (in “True to the Facts”, Davidson [1984]). Davidson also has argued that facts really are the true statements themselves; facts are not named by them, as the Correspondence Theory mistakenly supposes.

Defenders of the Correspondence Theory have responded to these criticisms in a variety of ways. Sense can be made of the term “correspondence”, some say, because speaking of propositions corresponding to facts is merely making the general claim that summarizes the remark that

(i) The sentence, “Snow is white”, means that snow is white, and (ii) snow actually is white,

and so on for all the other propositions. Therefore, the Correspondence theory must contain a theory of “means that” but otherwise is not at fault. Other defenders of the Correspondence Theory attack Davidson’s identification of facts with true propositions. Snow is a constituent of the fact that snow is white, but snow is not a constituent of a linguistic entity, so facts and true statements are different kinds of entities.

Recent work in possible world semantics has identified facts with sets of possible worlds. The fact that the cat is on the mat contains the possible world in which the cat is on the mat and Adolf Hitler converted to Judaism while Chancellor of Germany. The motive for this identification is that, if sets of possible worlds are metaphysically legitimate and precisely describable, then so are facts.

4. Tarski’s Semantic Theory

tarski To more rigorously describe what is involved in understanding truth and defining it, Alfred Tarski created his Semantic Theory of Truth. In Tarski’s theory, however, talk of correspondence and of facts is eliminated. (Although in early versions of his theory, Tarski did use the term “correspondence” in trying to explain his theory, he later regretted having done so, and dropped the term altogether since it plays no role within his theory.) The Semantic Theory is the successor to the Correspondence Theory.

For an illustration of the theory, consider the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” which means that snow is white. Tarski asks for the truth-conditions of the proposition expressed by that sentence: “Under what conditions is that proposition true?” Put another way: “How shall we complete the following in English: ‘The proposition expressed by the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” is true …’?” His answer:

The proposition expressed by the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if snow is white.

We can rewrite Tarski’s T-condition on three lines:

The proposition expressed by the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” is true
if and only if
snow is white

Line 1 is about truth. Line 3 is not about truth – it asserts a claim about the nature of the world. Thus T makes a substantive claim. Moreover, it avoids the main problems of the earlier Correspondence Theories in that the terms “fact” and “correspondence” play no role whatever.

A theory is a Tarskian truth theory for language L if and only if, for each sentence S of L, if S expresses the proposition that p, then the theory entails a true “T-proposition” of the bi-conditional form:

(T)

The proposition expressed by S-in-L is true, if and only if p.

In the example we have been using, namely, “Schnee ist weiss”, it is quite clear that the T-proposition consists of a containing (or “outer”) sentence in English, and a contained (or “inner” or quoted) sentence in German:

The proposition expressed by the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” is true if and only if snow is white.

There are, we see, sentences in two distinct languages involved in this T-proposition. If, however, we switch the inner, or quoted sentence, to an English sentence, e.g. to “Snow is white”, we would then have:

The proposition expressed by the English sentence “Snow is white” is true if and only if snow is white.

In this latter case, it looks as if only one language (English), not two, is involved in expressing the T-proposition. But, according to Tarski’s theory, there are still two languages involved: (i) the language one of whose sentences is being quoted and (ii) the language which attributes truth to the proposition expressed by that quoted sentence. The quoted sentence is said to be an element of the object language, and the outer (or containing) sentence which uses the predicate “true” is in the metalanguage.

Tarski discovered that in order to avoid contradiction in his semantic theory of truth, he had to restrict the object language to a limited portion of the metalanguage. Among other restrictions, it is the metalanguage alone that contains the truth-predicates, “true” and “false”; the object language does not contain truth-predicates.

It is essential to see that Tarski’s T-proposition is not saying:

Snow is white if and only if snow is white.

This latter claim is certainly true (it is a tautology), but it is no significant part of the analysis of the concept of truth – indeed it does not even use the words “true” or “truth”, nor does it involve an object language and a metalanguage. Tarski’s T-condition does both.

a. Extending the Semantic Theory Beyond “Simple” Propositions

Tarski’s complete theory is intended to work for (just about) all propositions, expressed by non-problematic declarative sentences, not just “Snow is white.” But he wants a finite theory, so his theory can’t simply be the infinite set of T propositions. Also, Tarski wants his truth theory to reveal the logical structure within propositions that permits valid reasoning to preserve truth. To do all this, the theory must work for more complex propositions by showing how the truth-values of these complex propositions depend on their parts, such as the truth-values of their constituent propositions. Truth tables show how this is done for the simple language of Propositional Logic (e.g. the complex proposition expressed by “A or B” is true, according to the truth table, if and only if proposition A is true, or proposition B is true, or both are true).

Tarski’s goal is to define truth for even more complex languages. Tarski’s theory does not explain (analyze) when a name denotes an object or when an object falls under a predicate; his theory begins with these as given. He wants what we today call a model theory for quantified predicate logic. His actual theory is very technical. It uses the notion of Gödel numbering, focuses on satisfaction rather than truth, and approaches these via the process of recursion. The idea of using satisfaction treats the truth of a simple proposition such as expressed by “Socrates is mortal” by saying:

If “Socrates” is a name and “is mortal” is a predicate, then “Socrates is mortal” expresses a true proposition if and only if there exists an object x such that “Socrates” refers to x and “is mortal” is satisfied by x.

For Tarski’s formal language of predicate logic, he’d put this more generally as follows:

If “a” is a name and “Q” is a predicate, then “a is Q” expresses a true proposition if and only if there exists an object x such that “a” refers to x and “Q” is satisfied by x.

The idea is to define the predicate “is true” when it is applied to the simplest (that is, the non-complex or atomic) sentences in the object language (a language, see above, which does not, itself, contain the truth-predicate “is true”). The predicate “is true” is a predicate that occurs only in the metalanguage, i.e., in the language we use to describe the object language. At the second stage, his theory shows how the truth predicate, when it has been defined for propositions expressed by sentences of a certain degree of grammatical complexity, can be defined for propositions of the next greater degree of complexity.

According to Tarski, his theory applies only to artificial languages – in particular, the classical formal languages of symbolic logic – because our natural languages are vague and unsystematic. Other philosophers – for example, Donald Davidson – have not been as pessimistic as Tarski about analyzing truth for natural languages. Davidson has made progress in extending Tarski’s work to any natural language. Doing so, he says, provides at the same time the central ingredient of a theory of meaning for the language. Davidson develops the original idea Frege stated in his Basic Laws of Arithmetic that the meaning of a declarative sentence is given by certain conditions under which it is true—that meaning is given by truth conditions.

As part of the larger program of research begun by Tarski and Davidson, many logicians, linguists, philosophers, and cognitive scientists, often collaboratively, pursue research programs trying to elucidate the truth-conditions (that is, the “logics” or semantics for) the propositions expressed by such complex sentences as:

	“It is possible that snow is white.”		[modal propositions]
	“Snow is white because sunlight is white.”		[causal propositions]
	“If snow were yellow, ice would melt at -4°C.”		[contrary-to-fact conditionals]
	“Napoleon believed that snow is white.”		[intentional propositions]
	“It is obligatory that one provide care for one’s children.”		[deontological propositions]
	etc.

Each of these research areas contains its own intriguing problems. All must overcome the difficulties involved with ambiguity, tenses, and indexical phrases.

b. Can the Semantic Theory Account for Necessary Truth?

Many philosophers divide the class of propositions into two mutually exclusive and exhaustive subclasses: namely, propositions that are contingent (that is, those that are neither necessarily-true nor necessarily-false) and those that are noncontingent (that is, those that are necessarily-true or necessarily-false).

On the Semantic Theory of Truth, contingent propositions are those that are true (or false) because of some specific way the world happens to be. For example all of the following propositions are contingent:

	Snow is white.		Snow is purple.
	Canada belongs to the U.N.		It is false that Canada belongs to the U.N.

The contrasting class of propositions comprises those whose truth (or falsehood, as the case may be) is dependent, according to the Semantic Theory, not on some specific way the world happens to be, but on any way the world happens to be. Imagine the world changed however you like (provided, of course, that its description remains logically consistent [i.e., logically possible]). Even under those conditions, the truth-values of the following (noncontingent) propositions will remain unchanged:

	Truths		Falsehoods
	Snow is white or it is false that snow is white.		Snow is white and it is false that snow is white.
	All squares are rectangles.		Not all squares are rectangles.
	2 + 2 = 4		2 + 2 = 7

However, some philosophers who accept the Semantic Theory of Truth for contingent propositions, reject it for noncontingent ones. They have argued that the truth of noncontingent propositions has a different basis from the truth of contingent ones. The truth of noncontingent propositions comes about, they say – not through their correctly describing the way the world is – but as a matter of the definitions of terms occurring in the sentences expressing those propositions. Noncontingent truths, on this account, are said to be true by definition, or – as it is sometimes said, in a variation of this theme – as a matter of conceptual relationships between the concepts at play within the propositions, or – yet another (kindred) way – as a matter of the meanings of the sentences expressing the propositions.

It is apparent, in this competing account, that one is invoking a kind of theory of linguistic truth. In this alternative theory, truth for a certain class of propositions, namely the class of noncontingent propositions, is to be accounted for – not in their describing the way the world is, but rather – because of certain features of our human linguistic constructs.

c. The Linguistic Theory of Necessary Truth

Does the Semantic Theory need to be supplemented in this manner? If one were to adopt the Semantic Theory of Truth, would one also need to adopt a complementary theory of truth, namely, a theory of linguistic truth (for noncontingent propositions)? Or, can the Semantic Theory of Truth be used to explain the truth-values of all propositions, the contingent and noncontingent alike? If so, how?

To see how one can argue that the Semantic Theory of Truth can be used to explicate the truth of noncontingent propositions, consider the following series of propositions, the first four of which are contingent, the fifth of which is noncontingent:

There are fewer than seven bumblebees or more than ten.
There are fewer than eight bumblebees or more than ten.
There are fewer than nine bumblebees or more than ten.
There are fewer than ten bumblebees or more than ten.
There are fewer than eleven bumblebees or more than ten.

Each of these propositions, as we move from the second to the fifth, is slightly less specific than its predecessor. Each can be regarded as being true under a greater range of variation (or circumstances) than its predecessor. When we reach the fifth member of the series we have a proposition that is true under any and all sets of circumstances. (Some philosophers – a few in the seventeenth century, a very great many more after the mid-twentieth century – use the idiom of “possible worlds”, saying that noncontingent truths are true in all possible worlds [i.e., under any logically possible circumstances].) On this view, what distinguishes noncontingent truths from contingent ones is not that their truth arises as a consequence of facts about our language or of meanings, etc.; but that their truth has to do with the scope (or number) of possible circumstances under which the proposition is true. Contingent propositions are true in some, but not all, possible circumstances (or possible worlds). Noncontingent propositions, in contrast, are true in all possible circumstances or in none. There is no difference as to the nature of truth for the two classes of propositions, only in the ranges of possibilities in which the propositions are true.

An adherent of the Semantic Theory will allow that there is, to be sure, a powerful insight in the theories of linguistic truth. But, they will counter, these linguistic theories are really shedding no light on the nature of truth itself. Rather, they are calling attention to how we often go about ascertaining the truth of noncontingent propositions. While it is certainly possible to ascertain the truth experientially (and inductively) of the noncontingent proposition that all aunts are females – for example, one could knock on a great many doors asking if any of the residents were aunts and if so, whether they were female – it would be a needless exercise. We need not examine the world carefully to figure out the truth-value of the proposition that all aunts are females. We might, for example, simply consult an English dictionary. How we ascertain, find out, determine the truth-values of noncontingent propositions may (but need not invariably) be by nonexperiential means; but from that it does not follow that the nature of truth of noncontingent propositions is fundamentally different from that of contingent ones.

On this latter view, the Semantic Theory of Truth is adequate for both contingent propositions and noncontingent ones. In neither case is the Semantic Theory of Truth intended to be a theory of how we might go about finding out what the truth-value is of any specified proposition. Indeed, one very important consequence of the Semantic Theory of Truth is that it allows for the existence of propositions whose truth-values are in principle unknowable to human beings.

And there is a second motivation for promoting the Semantic Theory of Truth for noncontingent propositions. How is it that mathematics is able to be used (in concert with physical theories) to explain the nature of the world? On the Semantic Theory, the answer is that the noncontingent truths of mathematics correctly describe the world (as they would any and every possible world). The Linguistic Theory, which makes the truth of the noncontingent truths of mathematics arise out of features of language, is usually thought to have great, if not insurmountable, difficulties in grappling with this question.

5. Coherence Theories

The Correspondence Theory and the Semantic Theory account for the truth of a proposition as arising out of a relationship between that proposition and features or events in the world. Coherence Theories (of which there are a number), in contrast, account for the truth of a proposition as arising out of a relationship between that proposition and other propositions.

Coherence Theories are valuable because they help to reveal how we arrive at our truth claims, our knowledge. We continually work at fitting our beliefs together into a coherent system. For example, when a drunk driver says, “There are pink elephants dancing on the highway in front of us”, we assess whether his assertion is true by considering what other beliefs we have already accepted as true, namely,

Elephants are gray.
This locale is not the habitat of elephants.
There is neither a zoo nor a circus anywhere nearby.
Severely intoxicated persons have been known to experience hallucinations.

But perhaps the most important reason for rejecting the drunk’s claim is this:

Everyone else in the area claims not to see any pink elephants.

In short, the drunk’s claim fails to cohere with a great many other claims that we believe and have good reason not to abandon. We, then, reject the drunk’s claim as being false (and take away the car keys).

Specifically, a Coherence Theory of Truth will claim that a proposition is true if and only if it coheres with ___. For example, one Coherence Theory fills this blank with “the beliefs of the majority of persons in one’s society”. Another fills the blank with “one’s own beliefs”, and yet another fills it with “the beliefs of the intellectuals in one’s society”. The major coherence theories view coherence as requiring at least logical consistency. Rationalist metaphysicians would claim that a proposition is true if and only if it “is consistent with all other true propositions”. Some rationalist metaphysicians go a step beyond logical consistency and claim that a proposition is true if and only if it “entails (or logically implies) all other true propositions”. Leibniz, Spinoza, Hegel, Bradley, Blanshard, Neurath, Hempel (late in his life), Dummett, and Putnam have advocated Coherence Theories of truth.

Coherence Theories have their critics too. The proposition that bismuth has a higher melting point than tin may cohere with my beliefs but not with your beliefs. This, then, leads to the proposition being both “true for me” but “false for you”. But if “true for me” means “true” and “false for you” means “false” as the Coherence Theory implies, then we have a violation of the law of non-contradiction, which plays havoc with logic. Most philosophers prefer to preserve the law of non-contradiction over any theory of truth that requires rejecting it. Consequently, if someone is making a sensible remark by saying, “That is true for me but not for you,” then the person must mean simply, “I believe it, but you do not.” Truth is not relative in the sense that something can be true for you but not for me.

A second difficulty with Coherence Theories is that the beliefs of any one person (or of any group) are invariably self-contradictory. A person might, for example, believe both “Absence makes the heart grow fonder” and “Out of sight, out of mind.” But under the main interpretation of “cohere”, nothing can cohere with an inconsistent set. Thus most propositions, by failing to cohere, will not have truth-values. This result violates the law of the excluded middle.

And there is a third objection. What does “coheres with” mean? For X to “cohere with” Y, at the very least X must be consistent with Y. All right, then, what does “consistent with” mean? It would be circular to say that “X is consistent with Y” means “it is possible for X and Y both to be true together” because this response is presupposing the very concept of truth that it is supposed to be analyzing.

Some defenders of the Coherence Theory will respond that “coheres with” means instead “is harmonious with”. Opponents, however, are pessimistic about the prospects for explicating the concept “is harmonious with” without at some point or other having to invoke the concept of joint truth.

A fourth objection is that Coherence theories focus on the nature of verifiability and not truth. They focus on the holistic character of verifying that a proposition is true but don’t answer the principal problem, “What is truth itself?”

a. Postmodernism: The Most Recent Coherence Theory

In recent years, one particular Coherence Theory has attracted a lot of attention and some considerable heat and fury. Postmodernist philosophers ask us to carefully consider how the statements of the most persuasive or politically influential people become accepted as the “common truths”. Although everyone would agree that influential people – the movers and shakers – have profound effects upon the beliefs of other persons, the controversy revolves around whether the acceptance by others of their beliefs is wholly a matter of their personal or institutional prominence. The most radical postmodernists do not distinguish acceptance as true from being true; they claim that the social negotiations among influential people “construct” the truth. The truth, they argue, is not something lying outside of human collective decisions; it is not, in particular, a “reflection” of an objective reality. Or, to put it another way, to the extent that there is an objective reality it is nothing more nor less than what we say it is. We human beings are, then, the ultimate arbiters of what is true. Consensus is truth. The “subjective” and the “objective” are rolled into one inseparable compound.

These postmodernist views have received a more sympathetic reception among social scientists than among physical scientists. Social scientists will more easily agree, for example, that the proposition that human beings have a superego is a “construction” of (certain) politically influential psychologists, and that as a result, it is (to be regarded as) true. In contrast, physical scientists are – for the most part – rather unwilling to regard propositions in their own field as somehow merely the product of consensus among eminent physical scientists. They are inclined to believe that the proposition that protons are composed of three quarks is true (or false) depending on whether (or not) it accurately describes an objective reality. They are disinclined to believe that the truth of such a proposition arises out of the pronouncements of eminent physical scientists. In short, physical scientists do not believe that prestige and social influence trump reality.

6. Pragmatic Theories

A Pragmatic Theory of Truth holds (roughly) that a proposition is true if it is useful to believe. Peirce and James were its principal advocates. Utility is the essential mark of truth. Beliefs that lead to the best “payoff”, that are the best justification of our actions, that promote success, are truths, according to the pragmatists.

The problems with Pragmatic accounts of truth are counterparts to the problems seen above with Coherence Theories of truth.

First, it may be useful for someone to believe a proposition but also useful for someone else to disbelieve it. For example, Freud said that many people, in order to avoid despair, need to believe there is a god who keeps a watchful eye on everyone. According to one version of the Pragmatic Theory, that proposition is true. However, it may not be useful for other persons to believe that same proposition. They would be crushed if they believed that there is a god who keeps a watchful eye on everyone. Thus, by symmetry of argument, that proposition is false. In this way, the Pragmatic theory leads to a violation of the law of non-contradiction, say its critics.

Second, certain beliefs are undeniably useful, even though – on other criteria – they are judged to be objectively false. For example, it can be useful for some persons to believe that they live in a world surrounded by people who love or care for them. According to this criticism, the Pragmatic Theory of Truth overestimates the strength of the connection between truth and usefulness.

Truth is what an ideally rational inquirer would in the long run come to believe, say some pragmatists. Truth is the ideal outcome of rational inquiry. The criticism that we don’t now know what happens in the long run merely shows we have a problem with knowledge, but it doesn’t show that the meaning of “true” doesn’t now involve hindsight from the perspective of the future. Yet, as a theory of truth, does this reveal what “true” means?

7. Deflationary Theories

What all the theories of truth discussed so far have in common is the assumption that a proposition is true just in case the proposition has some property or other – correspondence with the facts, satisfaction, coherence, utility, etc. Deflationary theories deny this assumption.

a. Redundancy Theory

The principal deflationary theory is the Redundancy Theory advocated by Frege, Ramsey, and Horwich. Frege expressed the idea this way:

It is worthy of notice that the sentence “I smell the scent of violets” has the same content as the sentence “It is true that I smell the scent of violets.” So it seems, then, that nothing is added to the thought by my ascribing to it the property of truth. (Frege, 1918)

When we assert a proposition explicitly, such as when we say “I smell the scent of violets”, then saying “It’s true that I smell the scent of violets” would be redundant; it would add nothing because the two have the same meaning. Today’s more minimalist advocates of the Redundancy Theory retreat from this remark about meaning and say merely that the two are necessarily equivalent.

Where the concept of truth really pays off is when we do not, or can not, assert a proposition explicitly, but have to deal with an indirect reference to it. For instance, if we wish to say, “What he will say tomorrow is true”, we need the truth predicate “is true”. Admittedly the proposition is an indirect way of saying, “If he says tomorrow that it will snow, then it will snow; if he says tomorrow that it will rain, then it will rain; if he says tomorrow that 7 + 5 = 12, then 7 + 5 = 12; and so forth.” But the phrase “is true” cannot be eliminated from “What he will say tomorrow is true” without producing an unacceptable infinite conjunction. The truth predicate “is true” allows us to generalize and say things more succinctly (indeed to make those claims with only a finite number of utterances). In short, the Redundancy Theory may work for certain cases, say its critics, but it is not generalizable to all; there remain recalcitrant cases where “is true” is not redundant.

Advocates of the Redundancy Theory respond that their theory recognizes the essential point about needing the concept of truth for indirect reference. The theory says that this is all that the concept of truth is needed for, and that otherwise its use is redundant.

b. Performative Theory

The Performative Theory is a deflationary theory that is not a redundancy theory. It was advocated by Strawson who believed Tarski’s Semantic Theory of Truth was basically mistaken.

The Performative Theory of Truth argues that ascribing truth to a proposition is not really characterizing the proposition itself, nor is it saying something redundant. Rather, it is telling us something about the speaker’s intentions. The speaker – through his or her agreeing with it, endorsing it, praising it, accepting it, or perhaps conceding it – is licensing our adoption of (the belief in) the proposition. Instead of saying, “It is true that snow is white”, one could substitute “I embrace the claim that snow is white.” The key idea is that saying of some proposition, P, that it is true is to say in a disguised fashion “I commend P to you”, or “I endorse P”, or something of the sort.

The case may be likened somewhat to that of promising. When you promise to pay your sister five dollars, you are not making a claim about the proposition expressed by “I will pay you five dollars”; rather you are performing the action of promising her something. Similarly, according to the Performative Theory of Truth, when you say “It is true that Vancouver is north of Sacramento”, you are performing the act of giving your listener license to believe (and to act upon the belief) that Vancouver is north of Sacramento.

Critics of the Performative Theory charge that it requires too radical a revision in our logic. Arguments have premises that are true or false, but we don’t consider premises to be actions, says Geach. Other critics complain that, if all the ascription of “is true” is doing is gesturing consent, as Strawson believes, then, when we say

“Please shut the door” is true,

we would be consenting to the door’s being shut. Because that is absurd, says Huw Price, something is wrong with Strawson’s Performative Theory.

c. Prosentential Theory

The Prosentential Theory of Truth suggests that the grammatical predicate “is true” does not function semantically or logically as a predicate. All uses of “is true” are prosentential uses. When someone asserts “It’s true that it is snowing”, the person is asking the hearer to consider the sentence “It is snowing” and is saying “That is true” where the remark “That is true” is taken holistically as a prosentence, in analogy to a pronoun. A pronoun such as “she” is a substitute for the name of the person being referred to. Similarly, “That is true” is a substitute for the proposition being considered. Likewise, for the expression “It is true.” According to the Prosentential Theory, all uses of “true” can be reduced to uses either of “That is true” or “It is true” or variants of these with other tenses. Because these latter prosentential uses of the word “true” cannot be eliminated from our language during analysis, the Prosentential Theory is not a redundancy theory.

Critics of the theory remark that it can give no account of what is common to all our uses of the word “true,” such as those in the unanalyzed operators “it-will-be-true-that” and “it-is-true-that” and “it-was-true-that”.

8. Related Issues

a. Beyond Truth to Knowledge

For generations, discussions of truth have been bedeviled by the question, “How could a proposition be true unless we know it to be true?” Aristotle’s famous worry was that contingent propositions about the future, such as “There will be a sea battle tomorrow”, couldn’t be true now, for fear that this would deny free will to the sailors involved. Advocates of the Correspondence Theory and the Semantic Theory have argued that a proposition need not be known in order to be true. Truth, they say, arises out of a relationship between a proposition and the way the world is. No one need know that that relationship holds, nor – for that matter – need there even be any conscious or language-using creatures for that relationship to obtain. In short, truth is an objective feature of a proposition, not a subjective one.

For a true proposition to be known, it must (at the very least) be a justified belief. Justification, unlike truth itself, requires a special relationship among propositions. For a proposition to be justified it must, at the very least, cohere with other propositions that one has adopted. On this account, coherence among propositions plays a critical role in the theory of knowledge. Nevertheless it plays no role in a theory of truth, according to advocates of the Correspondence and Semantic Theories of Truth.

Finally, should coherence – which plays such a central role in theories of knowledge – be regarded as an objective relationship or as a subjective one? Not surprisingly, theorists have answered this latter question in divergent ways. But the pursuit of that issue takes one beyond the theories of truth.

b. Algorithms for Truth

An account of what “true” means does not have to tell us what is true, nor tell us how we could find out what is true. Similarly, an account of what “bachelor” means should not have to tell us who is a bachelor, nor should it have to tell us how we could find out who is. However, it would be fascinating if we could discover a way to tell, for any proposition, whether it is true.

Perhaps some machine could do this, philosophers have speculated. For any formal language, we know in principle how to generate all the sentences of that language. If we were to build a machine that produces one by one all the many sentences, then eventually all those that express truths would be produced. Unfortunately, along with them, we would also generate all those that express false propositions. We also know how to build a machine that will generate only sentences that express truths. For example, we might program a computer to generate “1 + 1 is not 3”, then “1 + 1 is not 4”, then “1 + 1 is not 5”, and so forth. However, to generate all and only those sentences that express truths is quite another matter.

Leibniz (1646-1716) dreamed of achieving this goal. By mechanizing deductive reasoning he hoped to build a machine that would generate all and only truths. As he put it, “How much better will it be to bring under mathematical laws human reasoning which is the most excellent and useful thing we have.” This would enable one’s mind to “be freed from having to think directly of things themselves, and yet everything will turn out correct.” His actual achievements were disappointing in this regard, but his dream inspired many later investigators.

Some progress on the general problem of capturing all and only those sentences which express true propositions can be made by limiting the focus to a specific domain. For instance, perhaps we can find some procedure that will produce all and only the truths of arithmetic, or of chemistry, or of Egyptian political history. Here, the key to progress is to appreciate that universal and probabilistic truths “capture” or “contain” many more specific truths. If we know the universal and probabilistic laws of quantum mechanics, then (some philosophers have argued) we thereby indirectly (are in a position to) know the more specific scientific laws about chemical bonding. Similarly, if we can axiomatize an area of mathematics, then we indirectly have captured the infinitely many specific theorems that could be derived from those axioms, and we can hope to find a decision procedure for the truths, a procedure that will guarantee a correct answer to the question, “Is that true?”

Significant progress was made in the early twentieth century on the problem of axiomatizing arithmetic and other areas of mathematics. Let’s consider arithmetic. In the 1920s, David Hilbert hoped to represent the sentences of arithmetic very precisely in a formal language, then to generate all and only the theorems of arithmetic from uncontroversial axioms, and thereby to show that all true propositions of arithmetic can in principle be proved as theorems. This would put the concept of truth in arithmetic on a very solid basis. The axioms would “capture” all and only the truths. However, Hilbert’s hopes would soon be dashed. In 1931, Kurt Gödel (1906-1978), in his First Incompleteness Theorem, proved that any classical self-consistent formal language capable of expressing arithmetic must also contain sentences of arithmetic that cannot be derived within that system, and hence that the propositions expressed by those sentences could not be proven true (or false) within that system. Thus the concept of truth transcends the concept of proof in classical formal languages. This is a remarkable, precise insight into the nature of truth.

c. Can “is true” be Eliminated?

Can “is true” be defined so that it can be replaced by its definition? Unfortunately for the clarity of this question, there is no one concept of “definition”. A very great many linguistic devices count as definitions. These devices include providing a synonym, offering examples, pointing at objects that satisfy the term being defined, using the term in sentences, contrasting it with opposites, and contrasting it with terms with which it is often confused. (For further reading, see Definitions, Dictionaries, and Meanings.)

However, modern theories about definition have not been especially recognized, let alone adopted, outside of certain academic and specialist circles. Many persons persist with the earlier, naive, view that the role of a definition is only to offer a synonym for the term to be defined. These persons have in mind such examples as: “‘hypostatize’ means (or, is a synonym for) ‘reify’“.

If one were to adopt this older view of definition, one might be inclined to demand of a theory of truth that it provide a definition of “is true” which permitted its elimination in all contexts in the language. Tarski was the first person to show clearly that there could never be such a strict definition for “is true” in its own language. The definition would allow for a line of reasoning that produced the Liar Paradox (recall above) and thus would lead us into self contradiction. (See the discussion, in the article The Liar Paradox, of Tarski’s Udefinability Theorem of 1936.)

Kripke has attempted to avoid this theorem by using only a “partial” truth-predicate so that not every sentence has a truth-value. In effect, Kripke’s “repair” permits a definition of the truth-predicate within its own language but at the expense of allowing certain violations of the law of excluded middle.

d. Can a Theory of Truth Avoid Paradox?

The brief answer is, “Not if it contains its own concept of truth.” If the language is made precise by being formalized, and if it contains its own so-called global truth predicate, then Tarski has shown that the language will enable us to reason our way to a contradiction. That result shows that we do not have a coherent concept of truth (for a language within that language). Some of our beliefs about truth, and about related concepts that are used in the argument to the contradiction, must be rejected, even though they might seem to be intuitively acceptable.

There is no reason to believe that paradox is to be avoided by rejecting formal languages in favor of natural languages. The Liar Paradox first appeared in natural languages. And there are other paradoxes of truth, such as Löb’s Paradox, which follow from principles that are acceptable in either formal or natural languages, namely the principles of modus ponens and conditional proof.

The best solutions to the paradoxes use a similar methodology, the “systematic approach”. That is, they try to remove vagueness and be precise about the ramifications of their solutions, usually by showing how they work in a formal language that has the essential features of our natural language. The Liar Paradox and Löb’s Paradox represent a serious challenge to understanding the logic of our natural language. The principal solutions agree that – to resolve a paradox – we must go back and systematically reform or clarify some of our original beliefs. For example, the solution may require us to revise the meaning of “is true”. However, to be acceptable, the solution must be presented systematically and be backed up by an argument about the general character of our language. In short, there must be both systematic evasion and systematic explanation. Also, when it comes to developing this systematic approach, the goal of establishing a coherent basis for a consistent semantics of natural language is much more important than the goal of explaining the naive way most speakers use the terms “true” and “not true”. The later Wittgenstein did not agree. He rejected the systematic approach and elevated the need to preserve ordinary language, and our intuitions about it, over the need to create a coherent and consistent semantical theory.

e. Is The Goal of Scientific Research to Achieve Truth?

Except in special cases, most scientific researchers would agree that their results are only approximately true. Nevertheless, to make sense of this, philosophers need adopt no special concept such as “approximate truth.” Instead, it suffices to say that the researchers’ goal is to achieve truth, but they achieve this goal only approximately, or only to some approximation.

Other philosophers believe it’s a mistake to say the researchers’ goal is to achieve truth. These “scientific anti-realists” recommend saying that research in, for example, physics, economics, and meteorology, aims only for usefulness. When they aren’t overtly identifying truth with usefulness, the instrumentalists Peirce, James and Schlick take this anti-realist route, as does Kuhn. They would say atomic theory isn’t true or false but rather is useful for predicting outcomes of experiments and for explaining current data. Giere recommends saying science aims for the best available “representation”, in the same sense that maps are representations of the landscape. Maps aren’t true; rather, they fit to a better or worse degree. Similarly, scientific theories are designed to fit the world. Scientists should not aim to create true theories; they should aim to construct theories whose models are representations of the world.

9. References and Further Reading

Bradley, Raymond and Norman Swartz . Possible Worlds: an Introduction to Logic and Its Philosophy, Hackett Publishing Company, 1979.
Davidson, Donald. Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation, Oxford University Press, 1984.
Davidson, Donald. “The Structure and Content of Truth”, The Journal of Philosophy, 87 (1990), 279-328.
Horwich, Paul. Truth, Basil Blackwell Ltd., 1990.
Mates, Benson. “Two Antinomies”, in Skeptical Essays, The University of Chicago Press, 1981, 15-57.
McGee, Vann. Truth, Vagueness, and Paradox: An Essay on the Logic of Truth, Hackett Publishing, 1991.
Kirkham, Richard. Theories of Truth: A Critical Introduction, MIT Press, 1992.
Kripke, Saul. “Outline of a Theory of Truth”, Journal of Philosophy, 72 (1975), 690-716.
Quine, W. V. “Truth”, in Quiddities: An Intermittently Philosophical Dictionary, The Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, 1987.
Ramsey, F. P. “Facts and Propositions”, in Proceedings of the Arisotelian Society, Supplement, 7, 1927.
Russell, B. The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, 1912.
Strawson, P. F. “Truth”, in Analysis, vol. 9, no. 6, 1949.
Tarski, Alfred, “The Semantic Conception of Truth and the Foundations of Semantics”, in Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 4 (1944).
Tarski, Alfred. “The Concept of Truth in Formalized Languages”, in Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics, Clarendon Press, 1956.

Author Information

Bradley Dowden
Email: dowden@csus.edu
California State University Sacramento
U. S. A.

Norman Swartz
Email: swartz@sfu.ca
Simon Fraser University
Canada

Toleration

The heart of tolerance is self-control. When we tolerate an activity, we resist our urge to forcefully prohibit the expression of activities that we find unpleasant. More abstractly, toleration can be understood as a political practice aiming at neutrality, objectivity, or fairness on the part of political agents. These ideas are related in that the goal of political neutrality is deliberate restraint of the power that political authorities have to negate the life activities of its citizens and subjects. Related to toleration is the virtue of tolerance, which can be defined as a tendency toward toleration. Toleration is usually grounded upon an assumption about the importance of the autonomy of individuals. This assumption and the idea of toleration are central ideas in modern liberal theory and practice.

The virtue of toleration is implicit in Socrates’ method of allowing many diverse perspectives to be expressed. In seventeenth century Europe, the concept of tolerance was developed as liberal thinkers sought to limit the coercive actions of government and the Church. They argued that human beings are fallible and should have epistemic modesty. Further, an individual know his or her interests best and requires tolerance by others in order to find the best way to live.

The following article provides a conceptual and historical overview of the concept of toleration, surveying thinkers such as Socrates, John Locke, John Stuart Mill, Immanuel Kant, John Rawls and other contemporary political philosophers who have weighed in on this important yet problematic idea.

Conceptual Analysis
Historical Development
Epistemological Toleration
Moral Toleration
1. The Paradox of Toleration
2. Tolerance vs. Indifference
Political Toleration
1. John Rawls
2. Risks and Benefits
References and Further Reading

1. Conceptual Analysis

The English words, ‘tolerate’, ‘toleration’, and ‘tolerance’ are derived from the Latin terms tolerare and tolerantia, which imply enduring, suffering, bearing, and forbearance. Ancient Greek terms, which may also have influenced philosophical thinking on toleration, include: phoretos which means bearable, endurable, or phoreo, literally ‘to carry’; and anektikos meaning bearable, sufferable, tolerable, from anexo, ‘to hold up’.

Today, when we say that someone has a ‘high tolerance for pain,’ we mean that he or she is able to endure pain. This ordinary way of thinking is useful for understanding the idea of toleration and the virtue of tolerance: it underscores the fact that toleration is directed by an agent toward something perceived as negative. It would be odd to say, for example, that someone has a high tolerance for pleasure.

With this in mind, we can formulate a general definition of toleration that involves three interrelated conditions. When an agent tolerates something:

(1) the agent holds a negative judgment about this thing;

(2) the agent has the power to negate this thing; and

(3) the agent deliberately refrains from negation.

The first condition requires a negative judgment, which can be anything from disapproval to disgust. Judgment here is meant to be a broad concept that can include emotions, dispositions, tastes, and reasoned evaluations. This negative judgment inclines the agent toward a negative action toward the thing that is perceived as being negative. This broadly Stoic conception of judgment is a common assumption in discussions of toleration. Defenders of toleration assume that we can, to a certain extent, voluntarily control the expression of our negative reactions by opposing them with different, countervailing, judgments. Although judgments and emotions are both thought to have motivating force, they can be resisted by some other judgment, habit or virtue.

The entity toward which an agent has a negative judgment can be an event, an object, or a person, although with regard to tolerance as a moral and political disposition, the entity is usually thought to be a person. Although we speak of tolerating pain, for example, the moral and political emphasis is on tolerating some other person, a group of people, or their activities.

The second condition states that the agent has the power to negate the entity in question. Toleration is concerned with resisting the temptation to actively negate the thing in question. To distinguish toleration from cowardice or weakness of will the agent must have some capacity to enact his negative judgment. Toleration occurs when the agent could actively negate or destroy the person or object in question, but chooses not to.

The word negate is used here in a broad sense that allows for a variety of negative reactions. Negative actions can include: expressions of condemnation, acts of avoidance, or violent attacks. The continuum of negations is decidedly vague. It is not clear, for example, whether condemnation and avoidance are negations of the same sort as violent action. Despite the vagueness of the continuum of negative activities, the focal point of the second criterion is the power to negate: toleration is restraint of the power to negate.

The third condition states that the agent deliberately refrains from exercising his power to negate. Tolerant agents deliberately choose not to negate those things they view negatively. The negative formulation, ‘not negating,’ is important because toleration is not the same thing as positive evaluation, approbation, or approval.

Tolerant restraint of the negative judgment is supposed to be free and deliberate: one refrains from negating the thing because one has a reason not to negate it and is free to act. Good reasons for toleration are plural. They include: respect for autonomy; a general commitment to pacifism; concern for other virtues such as kindness and generosity; pedagogical concerns; a desire for reciprocity; and a sense of modesty about one’s ability to judge the beliefs and actions of others. Each of these provides us with a reason for thinking that it is good not to negate the thing in question. As mentioned already, there also may be other non-tolerant reasons for refraining from negation: fear, weakness of will, profit motive, self-interest, arrogance, and so forth.

Although there are many reasons to be tolerant, traditional discussions have emphasized respect for autonomy and pedagogical concerns. Underlying both of these approaches is often a form of self-conscious philosophical modesty that is linked to the value of respect for autonomy. As John Stuart Mill and others have argued, individuals ought to be left to pursue their own good in their own way in part because each individual knows himself and his own needs and interests best. This view does, however, leave us with a lingering problem as toleration can easily slip toward moral skepticism and relativism. It is important to note then that toleration is a positive value that is not based upon total moral skepticism. Proponents of toleration think that toleration is good not because they are unsure of their moral values but, rather, because toleration fits within a scheme of moral values that includes values such as autonomy, peace, cooperation, and other values that are thought to be good for human flourishing.

2. Historical Development

a. Early History

The spirit of tolerance is evident in Socrates’ dialogical method as a component of his search for truth. Throughout the early Platonic dialogues, Socrates tolerantly allows his interlocutors to pursue the truth wherever this pursuit might lead. And he encourages his interlocutors to offer refutations so that the truth might be revealed. Sometimes Socrates’ tolerance can appear to go too far. The Euthyrphro concludes, for example, with Socrates allowing Euthyphro to proceed in the prosecution of a questionable court case. And Socrates’ relationship with Alcibiades, as discussed in the Symposium, shows Socrates as perhaps too tolerant toward this reckless Athenian youth. In the Gorgias (at 458a) Socrates describes himself in terms that establish a link between philosophical method and a form of toleration. Socrates says,

And what kind of man am I? One of those who would gladly be refuted if anything I say is not true, and would gladly refute another who says what is not true, but would be no less happy to be refuted myself than to refute, for I consider that a greater benefit, inasmuch as it is a greater boon to be delivered from the worst of evils oneself than to deliver another.

For Socrates, then, the pursuit of truth is linked to an open mind, although of course this form of dialogical toleration is supposed to lead to a unitary vision of the truth.

One can see a more developed form of tolerance celebrated in the Stoicism of Epictetus (55-135 C.E.) and Marcus Aurelius (121-180 C.E.). The Stoic idea is that we should focus on those things we can control—our own opinions and behaviors—while ignoring those things we cannot control, especially the opinions and behaviors of others. The Stoic idea is linked to resignation and apathy, as is clear in the case of Epictetus, whose social position—raised as a Roman slave—might explain his advice about bearing and forbearing. Of course, the problem here is that slavish forbearance is not the same as tolerance: it seems clear that tolerance properly requires the power to negate, which the slave does not possess. With the Emperor Marcus Aurelius, however, tolerance is seen as a virtue of power. Tolerance might be linked to other virtues of power such as mercy and benevolence, as suggested, for example by Seneca. However, it is important to note that the Stoic approach to tolerance was not explicitly linked to a general idea about political respect for autonomy and freedom of conscience, as it is in the modern liberal tradition. Moreover, Roman political life was not nearly as tolerant as modern political life. For example, although Marcus’ Meditations contain many passages invoking the spirit of tolerance, Marcus was responsible for continuing the persecution of Christians.

Religious traditions provide further historical background for the idea of toleration. For example, the spirit of tolerance can be discovered in the Christian Gospel’s message of loving enemies, forgiving others, and refraining from judging others. Christian tolerance is linked to other virtues such as charity and self-sacrifice. Furthermore, it seems to go beyond tolerance toward a self-abnegating type of love and acceptance. Christ’s command to love your enemies is one example of this attempt to go beyond tolerance. It should be noted that other religious traditions also contain resources for developing toleration. For example, Buddhist compassion can be linked to the idea of toleration. Indeed, in the third century B.C.E., the Buddhist emperor of India, Ashoka, called for official religious toleration. Likewise, in the 16^th Century C.E., the Islamic emperor Akhbar made a similar attempt at establishing religious toleration on the Indian subcontinent.

Despite these antecedents, toleration does not become a serious subject of philosophical and political concern in Europe until the 16th and 17th Centuries. During the Renaissance and Reformation of the 15th and 16th Centuries, humanists such as Erasmus (1466-1536), De Las Casas (1484-1566), and Montaigne (1533-1592) asserted the autonomy of human reason against the dogmatism of the Church. Although religious authorities reacted with the formation of the Inquisition and the Index of Forbidden Books, by the 17^thCentury philosophers were seriously considering the question of toleration.

b. The 17th Century

Following the divisions created by the Lutheran Reformation and the Counter-Reformation, Europe was decimated by war and violence fomented in the name of religion, which culminated in the Thirty Years War (1618-1648). Through events such as these scholars became acutely aware of the destructive power of intolerance and sought to limit this destructive force by re-examining the biblical roots of toleration and by re-considering the relation between religious belief and political power. Additional influences on the cultural landscape of Europe during this time include the struggle to define sovereignty and to “purify” religion in Britain during the British Civil Wars (1640-1660), as well as increased information about cultural differences with the beginning of global exploration. Among the thinkers of this period, those who defended tolerance were Milton (1608-1674), Bayle (1647-1706), Spinoza (1634-1677), and Locke (1632-1704).

One of the worries of the humanist thinkers of the Reformation was whether it was possible to have infallible knowledge of the Divine Will such that one could justify the persecution of heretics. This concern with human fallibility lies at the heart of what will be described subsequently as “epistemological toleration.” When recognition of human fallibility is combined with critique of political and ecclesiastical power, more robust forms of political toleration develop.

In this vein, Spinoza concluded his Theological-Political Treatise (1670) with an argument for freedom of thought. It is not surprising that Spinoza should have written this treatise, for he was himself a product of a tolerant society: he was a Portuguese Jew living in Holland. Indeed, the 17^th Century saw the rise of toleration in practice in certain parts of Europe, perhaps as a result of increased trade and social mobility. Spinoza’s argument for toleration focuses on three claims: first, he claims that it is impossible for the state to effectively curtail liberty of thought; second, he claims that liberty of thought can in fact be allowed without detriment to state power; and finally, Spinoza argues that political authority should focus on controlling actions and not on restricting thought. This emphasis on the difference between thought and action is crucial for subsequent discussions of toleration in Locke, Mill, and Kant.

Somewhat different versions of Spinoza’s basic insights can be found in Locke’s famous Letter Concerning Toleration (1689), an essay that was written during Locke’s exile in Holland. Locke’s argument focuses specifically on the conflict between political authority and religious belief. He articulated a view of toleration based on the epistemological claim that it is impossible for the state to coerce genuine religious belief. He argued that the state should refrain from interfering in the religious beliefs of its subjects, except when these religious beliefs lead to behaviors or attitudes that run counter to the security of the state. This exception allowed him to conclude that the state need not tolerate Catholics who were loyal to a foreign authority or atheists whose lack of religious conviction left them entirely untrustworthy.

c. The 18th Century

In the 18^th Century, discussion of toleration was tied to the problem of skepticism and to a more sustained critique of absolutism in politics. Voltaire (1694-1778), who expressed his admiration for the development of religious tolerance in England in his Philosophical Letters (1734), was extremely worried about the tendency of religion to become violent and intolerant. Moreover, he suffered under the intolerant hands of the French authorities: he was thrown in jail for his views and his books were censored and publicly burned. Religious tolerance forms the theme of his Treatise on Tolerance (1763), which argues vigorously for tolerance even though it retains a bias toward Christianity. A concise summary of Voltaire’s argument for tolerance can be found in the entry on Tolerance in his Philosophical Dictionary (1764). Voltaire’s claim is that toleration follows from human frailty and error. Since none of us has perfect knowledge, and since we are all weak, inconsistent, liable to fickleness and error, we should pardon one another for our failings. Voltaire’s approach focuses on tolerance at the level of personal interaction and risks slipping toward moral skepticism and relativism: like his contemporary David Hume (1711-1777), Voltaire presented a skeptical challenge to orthodox belief.

Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), in response to skeptics such as Voltaire and Hume, tried to avoid skepticism while focusing on the limits of human knowledge and the limits of political power. In his essay, “What is Enlightenment?” (1784), Kant argues for an enlightened form of political power that would allow subjects to argue among themselves, so long as they remained obedient to authority. This position is further clarified by Kant’s claim in Perpetual Peace (1795) that philosophers should be allowed and encouraged to speak publicly. Kant’s point in this later essay is that public debate and discussion lead to the truth, and that kings should have nothing to fear from the truth. Kant’s views on religious toleration are clarified in his Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone (1793). Here Kant argues against religious intolerance by pointing out that although we are certain of our moral duties, human beings do not have apodictic certainty of God’s commands. Thus a religious belief that demands a contravention of morality (such as the burning of a heretic) can never be justified.

Bridging the gap between the Old World and the New World, the writings of Thomas Paine (1737-1809) and Thomas Jefferson (1743-1826) express a theory of toleration that is tied directly to political practice. Paine’s and Jefferson’s ideas followed Locke’s. Not only were they critical of unrestrained political power but they were also committed to an ecumenical approach to religious belief known as deism. Paine makes it clear in his Rights of Man (1791) that toleration for religious diversity is essential because political and ecclesiastical authorities do not have the capacity to adjudicate matters of conscience. “Mind thine own concerns. If he believes not as thou believest, it is a proof that thou believest not as he believeth, and there is no earthly power can determine between you.”

At the end of the 18th Century, we see tolerant ideas embodied in practice in the U.S. Constitution’s Bill of Rights—the first 10 Amendments to the Constitution (ratified in 1791). Collectively these amendments serve to restrain political power. Specifically, the First Amendment states that there can be no law, which prohibits freedom of religion, freedom of speech, freedom of the press, freedom of assembly, and freedom to petition to the government. Subsequent developments in U.S. Constitutional law have led to a tradition of respect for citizens’ freedom of thought, speech, and action.

d. The 19th Century

In the 19th Century, the idea of toleration was developed further in line with the liberal, enlightenment idea that moral autonomy is essential to human flourishing. The most famous argument for toleration in the 19^th Century was made by John Stuart Mill in On Liberty (1859). Mill argues here that the only proper limit of liberty is harm: one is entitled to be as free as possible, except where one’s liberty poses a threat to the well-being of someone else: “the only purpose for which power can rightfully be exercised over any member of a civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others.”

Mill expands the notion of privacy that was implicit in Locke and Kant to argue that political power should have no authority to regulate those activities and interests of individuals that are purely private and have no secondary effects on others. Mill also vigorously argues that freedom of thought is essential for the development of knowledge. Mill’s general approach is utilitarian: he claims that individuals will be happier if their private differences are tolerated and that society in general will be better off if individuals are left to pursue their own good in their own way.

In the 19th Century and into the early 20th Century, religious toleration was also a subject of consideration for thinkers such as Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855), Ralph Waldo Emerson (1803-1882), and William James (1842-1910), who emphasized the subjective nature of religious faith. For example, in his Varieties of Religious Experience (1902), James argued that religious experience was diverse and not subject to a definitive interpretation. Although this fits with James’s larger metaphysical commitment to pluralism, his point is that religious commitment is personal—a matter of what he calls in another essay, “the will to believe.” It is up to each individual to decide for himself what he will believe: if we properly understand the nature of religious belief, we should respect the religious liberty of others and learn to tolerate our differences.

e. The 20th Century

In the 20th Century, toleration has become an important component of what is now known as liberal theory. The bloody history of the 20th Century has led many to believe that toleration is needed to end political and religious violence. Toleration has been defended by liberal philosophers and political theorists such as John Dewey, Isaiah Berlin, Karl Popper, Michael Walzer, Ronald Dworkin, and John Rawls. It has been criticized by Herbert Marcuse and others such as Iris Young who worry that toleration and its ideal of state neutrality is merely another hegemonic Western ideology. Toleration has been the explicit subject of many recent works in political philosophy by Susan Mendus, John Horton, Preston King, and Bernard Williams. Much of the current discussion focuses on responding to John Rawls, whose theory of “political liberalism” conceives of toleration as a pragmatic response to the fact of diversity (see “Political Toleration” below). A recurring question in the current debate is whether there can be a more substantive commitment to toleration that does not lead to the paradoxical consequence that the tolerant must tolerate those who are intolerant.

Further recent discussion, by David Heyd, Glenn Newey, and others, has attempted to re-establish the link between tolerance and virtue. These writers wonder whether tolerance is in fact a virtue and if so, what sort of a virtue it is. A concern for racial equality, gender neutrality, an end of prejudice, respect for cultural and ethnic difference, and a general commitment to multiculturalism has fueled ongoing debates about the nature of toleration in our age of globalization and homogenization. Finally, in the U.S., First Amendment Law has developed to allow for a broad idea of freedom of speech, freedom of the press, and freedom of religion. And under the influence of an interpretation of the equal protection clause of the 14th Amendment, mechanisms to ensure equality have given support to those minority groups who were once the victims of political intolerance.

3. Epistemological Toleration

An epistemological argument for toleration can be traced to Socrates. However, this ideal becomes explicit in the thinking of Milton, Locke, and Mill. The epistemological claim is that one should tolerate the opinions and beliefs of the other because it is either impossible to coerce belief or because such coercion is not the most useful pedagogical approach. This idea can be developed into a claim about the importance of diversity, dialogue, and debate for the establishment of truth. Finally, this approach might lead to a form of relativism or skepticism that puts the idea of toleration itself at risk.

a. Socrates

Socratic tolerance is discovered if we take seriously Socrates’ claims to ignorance. Socratic ignorance is linked to virtues, such as sophrosyne (self-control), modesty and tolerance. These virtues are essential components in the formation of the philosophical community and the pursuit of philosophical truth. Throughout Plato’s dialogues, Socrates restrains himself deliberately—he modestly claims ignorance and allows others to develop their own positions and make their own mistakes—out of recognition that this is the best, perhaps the only, way to proceed in the communal pursuit of truth. Socrates’ main goal is to discover the truth through open-minded debate. But there would be no dialogue and indeed no education without tolerance. Socrates’ commitment to tolerance is part of his epistemological faith in the autonomy of reason. We each must discover the truth for ourselves by way of disciplined, modest, and tolerant dialogue.

b. Milton

Centuries later, John Milton’s Areopagitica (1644) offers a similar defense of the truth. Milton vigorously defended freedom of speech in response to a censorship decree of the English parliament. His argument relies upon the epistemological claim that open dialogue supported by a tolerant government fosters the development of truth. Milton’s basic assumption is that the truth is able to defend itself in a free debate. “Let truth and falsehood grapple; who ever knew truth put to the worse, in a free and open encounter?” Milton further argues that outward conformity to orthodoxy is not the same as genuine belief.

c. Locke

These ideas were developed further by Locke in his Letter Concerning Toleration. Locke argues that the civil and ecclesiastical authorities ought to tolerate diversity of belief because one cannot force another human being to have faith. In a claim that is reminiscent of Milton, Locke claims “the truth certainly would do well enough if she were left to shift for herself… She is not taught by laws, nor has she any need of force to procure her entrance into the minds of men.” This is so because the authority of judgment resides within the free individual. It is impossible to force someone to believe something for external reasons. Rather, truth must be arrived at and believed for internal reasons.

This epistemological claim is the focal point of Jeremy Waldron’s recent critique of Locke’s account. Waldron claims that Locke’s argument is weak because it relies upon the false assumption that beliefs cannot be coerced. The point is that we often believe things quite sincerely without any good reason whatsoever. Moreover, Waldron argues that the epistemological argument is too weak to provide a moral limitation on coercion. Even though coercion cannot produce genuine belief, an intolerant regime may not be interested in producing genuine belief. It may simply be interested in guaranteeing conformity. Waldron’s point is important: the epistemological critique is useful only if one is committed to the claim that genuine belief in the truth is an important political or moral value. An epistemological argument for toleration must claim not only that it is impractical or impossible to impose belief upon others, but also that we ought to value genuine commitment over mere conformity.

d. Mill

Mill’s epistemological argument is quite similar to Locke’s, although Mill goes farther in advocating freedom of speech as essential for the discovery of truth. Mill’s epistemological argument begins with the assumption that individuals know best what is good for them. This claim runs counter to the traditional Platonic claim that often individuals do not know what is in their own best interest. Mill supports his claim by pointing out that the individual always has the best access to his/her own interests and desires: others do not have access to the kinds of internal evidence that would allow them to judge for the individual. It is important to note that Mill does not equate this access problem with relativism. Indeed, in his essay Utilitarianism (1863), he famously defends a hierarchy of goods based on the fact that those who have experienced both “lower” and “higher” goods will prefer the higher ones (for example, “it is better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied”). The epistemological point remains the same here, however: it is up to the individual to judge for himself about what is good for him.

Mill’s general argument for freedom of thought is based upon a recognition of human fallibility and on the need for dialogue and debate. Mill’s argument for freedom of thought in On Liberty contains the following claims. (1) Silenced opinions may be true. To assume they are not is to assume that we are infallible. (2) Even false opinions may contain valid points of contention and parts of the truth. To know the whole of truth we might have to weave together parts of truth from different sources. (3) To claim to know the truth means that we are able to defend it against all vigorous opposition. Thus we need to be able to hear and respond to false opinions in order to know all of the arguments for a proposition. (4) Truth that is not continuously and vigorously contested becomes mere superstition. Such dogmatically held superstitions may thus crumble before even weak opposition and will not be heartily believed or defended.

e. The Problem of Relativism

Like Socrates, Mill and Locke both arrive at the notion of toleration from a non-relativistic understanding of belief and truth. However, under the general rubric of epistemological toleration we might also include the sort of toleration that follows from skepticism or relativism. For the relativist or skeptic, since we cannot know the truth or since all truths are relative, we ought to be tolerant of those who hold different points of view. Contemporary American philosopher, Richard Rorty has articulated an argument something like this. The problem with this approach is the same problem with all sorts of skepticism and relativism: either the claim self-referentially undermines itself or it provides us with no compelling reason to believe it. If we are skeptical about knowledge, then we have no way of knowing that toleration is good. Likewise, if truth is relative to a system of thought, then the claim that toleration is required is itself merely a relatively justified claim. The form of epistemological toleration espoused by Mill, at least, attempts to avoid these problems by appealing to a form of fallibilism that is not completely skeptical or relativistic. Mill’s point is not that there is no truth but, rather, that toleration is required for us to come to know the truth.

4. Moral Toleration

We have seen that epistemological concerns can lead us to toleration. Moral concerns can also bring us to toleration. Tolerance as a moral virtue might be linked to other moral virtues such as modesty and self-control. However, the most common moral value that is thought to ground toleration is a concern for autonomy. We ought to refrain from negating the other when concern for the other’s autonomy provides us with a good reason not to act. Toleration that follows from a commitment to autonomy should not be confused with moral relativism. Moral relativism holds that values are relative to culture or context. A commitment to autonomy, in opposition to this, holds that autonomy is good in a non-relative sense. A commitment to autonomy might require that I allow another person to do something that I find abhorrent, not because I believe that values are relative, but because I believe that autonomy is so important that it requires me to refrain from negating the autonomous action of another free agent. Of course, there are limits here. Autonomous action that violates the autonomy of another cannot be tolerated.

Mill’s account of the principle of liberty is helpful for understanding this idea of toleration. Mill tells us that we should be given as much liberty as possible, as long as our liberty does not harm others. This is in fact a recipe for toleration. Mill’s argument follows from certain basic assumptions about individuals.

1. Each individual has a will of his own.
2. Each individual is better off when not compelled to do better.
3. Each individual knows best what is good for him.
4. Each individual is motivated to attain his own good and to avoid actions that are contrary to his self-interest.
5. Self-regarding thought and activity can be distinguished from its effects upon others.

Some of these claims (for example, #3) are linked to epistemological toleration. However, the point here is not only that individuals know what is in their own self-interest but also that it is good for individuals to be able to pursue their own good in their own way. Such an approach makes several important metaphysical assumptions about the nature of human being: that autonomy is possible and important, that individuals do know their own good, that there is a distinction between self-regarding action and actions that effects others. Moral toleration follows from these sorts of claims about human being.

a. The Paradox of Toleration

Of course, toleration and respect for autonomy are not simple ideas. Much has been made about the so-called “paradox of toleration”: the fact that toleration seems to ask us to tolerate those things we find intolerable. Toleration does require that we refrain from enacting the negative consequences of our negative judgments. This becomes paradoxical when we find ourselves confronting persons, attitudes, or behaviors, which we vigorously reject: we then must, paradoxically, tolerate that which we find intolerable. This becomes especially difficult when the other who is to be tolerated expresses views or activities that are themselves intolerant.

One way of resolving this paradox is to recognize that there is a distinction between first-order judgments and second-order moral commitments. First-order judgments include emotional reactions and other practical judgments that focus on concrete and particular attitudes and behaviors. Second-order moral commitments include more complicated judgments that aim beyond emotion and particularity toward rational universal principles. With regard to the paradox of toleration there is a conflict between a first-order reaction against something and a second-order commitment to the principle of respecting autonomy or to the virtues of modesty or self-control. The paradox is resolved by recognizing that this second-order commitment trumps the first-order reaction: principle is supposed to outweigh emotion. Thus we might have good reasons (based upon our second-order commitments) to refrain from following through on the normal consequences of negative first-order judgments. However, when there is a genuine conflict of second-order commitments, that is, when the tolerant commitment to autonomy runs up against an intolerant rejection of autonomy, then there is no need to tolerate. In other words the paradox is resolved when we realize that toleration is not a commitment to relativism but, rather, that it is a commitment to the value of autonomy and to the distinction between first-order judgments and second-order moral commitments.

b. Tolerance vs. Indifference

Of course, the ideal of toleration is a difficult one to enact. This difficulty is related to the tension between first-order reactions and second-order commitments that is found within the spiritual economy of an individual. This is why the idea of tolerance as a virtue is important. Virtues are tendencies or habits toward good action. In the case of the virtue of tolerance, the tendency is toward respect for the autonomy of others and toward the self-discipline necessary for deliberately restraining first-order reactions. Virtues are usually thought to be integrated into a system of virtues. Tolerance is no exception. The virtue of tolerance is closely related to other virtues such as self-control, modesty, generosity, kindness, mercy, and forgiveness. One must be careful, however, not to conclude that the virtue of tolerance is a tendency toward indifference or apathy. Tolerance demands that we moderate and control our passions in light of some larger good, whether that good be respect for autonomy or an interest in self-control; tolerance does not demand that we completely refrain from judging another free agent.

Moral toleration asks us to restrain some of our most powerful first-order reactions: negative reactions to persons, attitudes, and behaviors which we find repugnant. Without the tension between first-order reactions and second-order commitment, toleration is merely indifference. Indifference usually indicates a failure at the level of first-order judgment: when we are indifferent, we do not have any reaction, negative or positive, to the other. Such a state of indifference is not virtuous. Indeed, it would be vicious and wrong not to react strongly against injustice or violations of autonomy.

We often confuse indifference with toleration. However, indifference is flawed as a human response for two reasons. First, it rejects the truth of first-order reactions. First-order reactions should not be ignored. Our emotional responses are important ways in which we connect with the world around us. When we react negatively to something, this emotional reaction provides important information about the world and ourselves. Tolerance does not ask us to deaden our emotional responses to others; rather it asks us to restrain the negative consequences of our negative emotional responses out of deference to a more universal set of commitments. Second, indifference is often closely related to general skepticism about moral judgment. The moral skeptic claims that no set of values is true. From this perspective, both first-order reactions and second-order commitments are mere tastes or preferences without any final moral significance. From this skepticism, indifference with regard to any moral evaluation is cultivated because all of our moral values are thought to be equally groundless. The difficulty here is that moral skepticism cannot lead to the conclusion that it is good to be tolerant, since the skeptic holds that no moral value can be justified. If we claim that toleration is good and that tolerance is a virtue, toleration cannot be the same thing as indifference.

This distinction between tolerance and indifference is important for explaining the spiritual disruption that occurs when we strive to become tolerant. Indeed, the difficulty of toleration can be understood in terms of the difficulty of the middle path between indifference and dogmatism. Indifference is easy and satisfying because it sets us free, as it were, from the difficult human task of judging. Likewise, dogmatism is easy and satisfying because it follows from a seamless synthesis of first-order reaction and second-order commitment. Toleration is the middle path in which there is a conflict between first-order reaction and second-order commitment. Toleration thus requires self-consciousness and self-control in order to coordinate conflicting parts of the spiritual economy. The discipline required for toleration is part of any idea of education: we must learn to distance ourselves from first-order reactions in order to move toward universal principles. First-order reactions are often wrong or incomplete, as are immediate sense perceptions. And yet, education does not ask us to give up on first-order reactions or sense perceptions. Rather, it asks us to be disciplined and self-critical, so that we might control first-order reactions in order to uphold more important principles.

5. Political Toleration

Moral toleration emphasizes a moral commitment to the value of autonomy. Although it is linked, by Mill, for example to a political idea about restraint of state power, moral toleration is ultimately concerned with clarifying the second-order principle that is supposed to lead to toleration.

While moral toleration is about relations between agents, political toleration is about restraint of political power. The modern liberal state is usually not thought to be a moral agent. Rather, the state is supposed to be something like a third party referee: it is not thought to be one of the parties engaged directly in the process of judgment and negation. Political toleration is thus an ideal that holds that the political referee should be impartial and unbiased. The term toleration has been used, since Locke, in this political context to describe a principle of state neutrality. The connection between moral and political toleration can be understood in terms of the history of the pre-modern era when the state was an agent—a monarch, for example—who had particular judgments and the power to negate. As the idea of the state has evolved since the 17th Century toward liberal democratic notions of self-government and civil rights, the notion of political toleration has evolved to mean something like state indifference. Political toleration is now thought to entail respect for privacy, separation of church and state, and a general respect for human rights.

a. John Rawls

In the 20th Century, the idea of political toleration has developed, especially under the influence of John Rawls (1921-2002) and his books, Theory of Justice (1971) and Political Liberalism (1995). Rawls’ approach attempts to be neutral about moral values in order to establish political principles of toleration. Rawls argues for toleration in a pragmatic fashion as that which works best to achieve political unity and an idea of justice among diverse individuals. Although the idea of political toleration has been most vigorously defended by Rawls, it also forms the basis of other pragmatic and political accounts of toleration, including those of John Dewey, Jürgen Habermas, Michael Walzer, and Richard Rorty. The danger with this approach is that it tends toward relativism by self-consciously limiting itself from articulating a metaphysical defense of autonomy and toleration. The difficulty is that the idea of state neutrality can become paradoxical: a state that is neutral about everything will undermine its own existence.

The idea of political toleration begins from the claim that diverse individuals will come to tolerate one another by developing what Rawls called “overlapping consensus”: individuals and groups with diverse metaphysical views or comprehensive schemes will find reasons to agree about certain principles of justice that will include principles of toleration. This is in part an empirical or historical argument about the way in which diverse individuals or groups eventually resolve their differences by way of a pragmatic commitment to toleration as a modus vivendi, or means of life. One could trace this idea back to Hobbes’ idea of the social contract as a peace treaty. Diverse individuals in the state of nature will, according to Hobbes’s argument in The Leviathan (1651), engage in the war of all against all. This war is ultimately unsatisfying and so individuals relinquish their warring power and create the social contract. The problem is that this pragmatic account leaves us without a metaphysical justification of the principles of toleration. Rather it comes to toleration from the pragmatic assumption that diverse individuals motivated by self-interest will agree to support the neutral state, which is then supposed to act as a referee in their disputes. Of course, Hobbes’ account of the absolute sovereignty of the Leviathan calls into question the idea that a social contract view will always lead to a tolerant liberal state.

Rawls’ idea of “justice as fairness” attempts to set limits to political power without trying to evaluate the relative merits of different conceptions of the good. Rawls clarified his approach by insisting that the principles of justice are political and not moral principles. They are based upon what he called “reasonable pluralism.” What he means by this is that the principles of toleration will be agreed to by individuals from diverse perspectives because these principles will appear reasonable to each individual despite their differences. The idea of toleration results from a political consensus that is developed by way of the ideal social contract that Rawls describes at length in Theory of Justice. Like Mill, Rawls theory of justice claims that the first principle of justice is the liberty principle: “Each person has an equal right to a fully adequate scheme of equal basic liberties which is compatible with a similar scheme of liberties for all.” These basic civil liberties form the basis for political toleration.

b. Risks and Benefits

Political liberalism focuses on the problem of diversity without appealing to a larger metaphysical theory. This problem is exacerbated when political liberalism takes up the question of international human rights and the problem of intolerant groups or individual who demand to be tolerated. Political liberalism aims at the creation of a global human rights regime that is supposed to support politically tolerant states and that is sensitive to the issue of group rights. From the perspective of political liberalism, human rights—basic defenses against the intolerant expansion of state power—are thought to be the result of overlapping political consensus. From this perspective, human rights, such as the right to autonomy that forms the basis of moral toleration, are thought to be, not metaphysical givens, but the conditions for the possibility of political consensus building.

The idea of a developing “overlapping consensus” in international affairs was articulated in the 1950’s by Jacques Maritain and was developed in practice by international agencies such as the United Nations. In the final decade of the twentieth century, Jürgen Habermas’ approach linked principles of toleration to the very nature of political argument: for us to have a political argument, we must agree to certain principles of fair argumentation. The difficultly here is that diversity is even more of a problem on the international scene, where discussions of human rights are essential. At the local or national level, the point of liberalism is that the neutral state ought not interfere or comment on the quality of individual lives unless the lives and actions of private individuals become a menace to the rights and privacy of other individuals. Internationally, Rawls follows Kant in specifying the Law of Peoples that is supposed to maintain order among diverse mutually tolerant nations.

A further complication arises at the level of group rights (both within national and international politics), where groups and their members claim the right to be tolerated by larger political organizations. Here the idea of tolerating the practices and identities of groups may paradoxically result in toleration for intolerant groups. This is the case for example, when tolerant governments consider groups who advocate violence, discrimination, and other intolerant practices. Such groups can be intolerant toward their own members, toward the tolerant liberal societies in which they subside, and indeed toward those international organizations who support toleration throughout the globe.

The risk of political liberalism is that it hovers uneasily between pluralism and relativism, while seeking to avoid metaphysical dogmatism or political imperialism. The basic pluralism of political liberalism supports political toleration by recognizing that conflicting comprehensive doctrines can each be justified as reasonable according to the standards internal to them. This leaves us with the conflicts of reasonable pluralism: each of the conflicting comprehensive doctrines is reasonable on its own terms and to the extent that it recognizes the reasonableness of other comprehensive doctrines. Thus, for Rawls, cooperation between reasonable comprehensive doctrines is a practical political task. The state should refrain from entering into a discussion of which comprehensive doctrine is better morally, epistemologically, or metaphysically quite simply because such a discussion would be unjust for a neutral state confronted with the fact of diversity. By defining his account of state neutrality as political, Rawls wants to distance his account of reasonable pluralism from a more robust form of philosophical skepticism. This is reminiscent of Locke’s approach to epistemological toleration: since we cannot in practice force individuals to agree about moral or metaphysical truths, we should tolerate diversity at the political level.

Rawls does, however, hold that there is a best political arrangement, even if the truth about the best political arrangement is arrived at by way of pragmatic concerns for what works politically in light of the fact of diversity. And thus his idea of political consensus tries to avoid the slide toward skepticism and relativism. It seems that for political toleration, there is at least one non-relative value—that of toleration and peaceful coexistence—even if this is merely pragmatically justified by the concrete historical need for peaceful coexistence among those who cannot arrive at consensus about their views of the good.

The approach of political liberalism has appeared to succeed in practice. One could argue that the idea of the neutral state and of political consensus about the need for toleration has been gradually developing in Constitutional Law in the U.S. and in international law by way of the U.N.’s Declaration of Human Rights. Article 26 of the U.N. Declaration states explicitly that education is a universal right and that education should aim to “promote understanding, tolerance and friendship among all nations, racial or religious groups.” We are still far from actualizing the idea of a tolerant international community. However, it is fairly clear that in the last several decades the idea of political toleration has succeeded in the United States and in other Western countries.

Despite this success, critics such as Michael Sandel, in his Democracy’s Discontent (1998), have argued that the tolerant attitude of what he calls “the procedural republic” must be grounded in a more comprehensive moral theory. Without such a ground, Sandel worries that the tolerant neutral state will ultimately lose its connection with the moral lives of individuals. Sandel claims in his arguments against Rawls and against certain developments in Constitutional Law that the approach of political liberalism cannot ultimately take account of the depth of commitment that most individuals have to their own comprehensive doctrines. Rawls admits that for his idea of overlapping consensus to work, he must assume a weakening of private faith in comprehensive doctrines. The problem here is that it argues for toleration by underestimating the power of those forms of private faith that must be tolerated.

A further problem of the political approach to toleration is that it struggles to define the nature of privacy. Moral toleration claims that there are certain private activities which are only of concern to the individual and that the state would be unjustified in interfering with these private activities. A merely political approach to toleration is however unable to draw the line dividing public and private in a metaphysical fashion. Rather, the sphere of privacy is itself defined only as a result of the process of building political consensus. Thus the worry is that the principles of political liberalism are not clearly defined and that toleration, as a mere modus vivendi, could be violated if the political consensus were to shift. In other words, if there is no metaphysical basis for a sphere of privacy, then it is not exactly clear what the politically grounded idea of liberal toleration is supposed to tolerate.

6. References and Further Reading

Beiner, Ronald. What’s the Matter with Liberalism (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1992).
Berlin, Isaiah. “Two Concepts of Liberty” in Four Essays on Liberty(Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1969).
Cook, John W. Morality and Cultural Differences (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999).
Dworkin, Ronald. Sovereign Virtue (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2000).
Dworkin, Ronald. Taking Rights Seriously (Cambridge: Harvard, 1977).
Fiala, Andrew. “Toleration and Pragmatism” in Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 16: 2, (2002), 103-116.
Habermas, Jürgen. Moral Consciousness and Communicative Action (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1990).
Heyd, David, ed. Toleration: An Elusive Virtue (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1996).
Horton, John and Peter Nicholson, eds. Toleration: Philosophy and Practice (London: Ashgate Publishing, 1992).
King, Preston. Toleration (London: Frank Cass, 1998).
Kymlicka, Will. Liberalism, Community, and Culture (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1989).
Laursen, John Christian. “Spinoza on Toleration” in Difference and Dissent: Theories of Tolerance in Medieval and Early Modern Europe, edited by Nederman and Laursen (Lanham, Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield, 1996).
Locke, John. Letter Concerning Toleration in Steven M. Cahn ed. Classics of Modern Political Theory (New York: Oxford University Press, 1997).
Mara, Gerald M. “Socrates and Liberal Toleration” in Political Theory, 16:3 (1988).
Marcuse, Herbert. “Repressive Tolerance” in Wolff, Moore, and Marcuse, eds., A Critique of Pure Tolerance (Boston: Beacon Press, 1969).
Maritain, Jacques. Man and the State (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1951).
Mendus, Susan and David Edwards, eds. On Toleration (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1987).
Mendus, Susan. “Locke: Toleration, Morality, and Rationality” in John Horton and Susan Mendus, eds., John Locke: A Letter Concerning Toleration in Focus (London: Routledge, 1991).
Mendus, Susan. Toleration and the Limits of Liberalism (Atlantic Highlands, NJ: Humanities Press International, 1989).
Mill, John Stuart. On Liberty and Other Essays (Oxford: Oxford World Classics, 1998).
Milton, John. Aereopogatica in Encyclopedia Britannica’s Great Books of the Western World, vol. 29 (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1991).
Newey, Glen. Virtue, Reason, and Toleration (Edinburgh: University of Edinburgh Press, 1999).
Oberdiek, Hans. Tolerance: Between Forbearance and Acceptance (Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield, 2001).
Paine, Thomas. The Complete Writings of Thomas Paine ed. by Philip Foner (New York: The Citadel Press, 1945).
Popper, Karl. The Open Society and its Enemies (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1971).
Rawls, John. A Theory of Justice (Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1971).
Rawls, John. Justice as Fairness: A Restatement (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2001).
Rawls, John. Political Liberalism (New York: Columbia University Press, 1995).
Rawls, John. The Law of Peoples (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2001).
Razavi, Mehdi Amin and David Ambuel, eds. Philosophy, Religion, and the Question of Intolerance (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1997).
Ricoeur, Paul, ed. Tolerance Between Intolerance and the Intolerable (an edition of Diogenes, No. 176, Vol. 44/4, Winter 1996).
Rorty, Richard. Contingency, Irony, Solidarity (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989).
Rosenthal, Michael A. “Tolerance as a Virtue in Spinoza’s Ethics” in Journal of the History of Philosophy 39:4 (2001), 535-557.
Sandel, Michael. Democracy’s Discontent (Cambridge: Harvard, 1998).
Sandel, Michael. Liberalism and the Limits of Justice (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982).
Sen, Amartya. “Human Rights and Asian Values” in The New Republic 217: 2-3 (1997), 33-40.
Spinoza, Baruch. Theological-Political Treatise and Political Treatise (New York: Dover Publications, 1951).
Tan, Kok-Chor. Toleration, Diversity, and Global Justice (University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 2000).
Voltaire. Philosophical Dictionary (Cleveland: World Publishing Co., 1943).
Waldron, Jeremy. “Locke: Toleration and the Rationality of Persecution” in John Horton and Susan Mendus eds., John Locke: A Letter Concerning Toleration in Focus (London: Routledge, 1991).
Walzer, Michael. On Toleration (New Haven: Yale University Press, 1997).

Author Information

Andrew Fiala
Email: fialaa@uwgb.edu
University of Wisconsin — Green Bay
U. S. A.

Time Travel

time-tra Time travel is commonly defined with David Lewis’ definition: An object time travels if and only if the difference between its departure and arrival times as measured in the surrounding world does not equal the duration of the journey undergone by the object. For example, Jane is a time traveler if she travels away from home in her spaceship for one hour as measured by her own clock on the ship but travels two hours as measured by the clock back home, assuming both clocks are functioning properly.

Before the twentieth century, scientists and philosophers rarely investigated time travel, but now it is an exciting and deeply studied topic. There are investigations into travel to the future and travel to the past, although travel to the past is more problematical and receives more attention. There are also investigations of the logical possibility of time travel, the physical possibility of time travel, and the technological practicality of time travel. The most attention is paid to time travel that is consistent with current physical theory such as Einstein’s general theory of relativity. In science, different models of the cosmos and the laws of nature governing the universe imply different possibilities for time travel. So, theories about time travel have changed radically as the dominant cosmological theories have evolved from classical, Newtonian conceptions to modern, relativistic and quantum mechanical conceptions. Philosophers were quick to note some of the implications of the new physics for venerable issues in metaphysics: the nature of time, causation and personal identity, to name just a few. The subject continues to produce a fruitful cross-fertilization of ideas between scientists and philosophers as theorists in both fields struggle to resolve confounding paradoxes that emerge when time travel is pondered seriously. This article discusses both the scientific and philosophical issues relevant to time travel.

Introduction
Definition
Time in Philosophy
Time in Physics
Causation
1. The Grandfather Paradox
2. Causal Loops
Personal Identity
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Time travel stories have been a staple of the science fiction genre for the past century. Good science fiction stories often pay homage to the fundamentals of scientific knowledge of the time. Thus, we see time travel stories of the variety typified by H. G. Wells as set within the context of a Newtonian universe: a three-dimensional Euclidean spatial manifold that changes along an inexorable arrow of time. By the early to mid-twentieth century, time travel stories evolved to take into account the features of an Einsteinian universe: a four-dimensional spacetime continuum that curves and in which time has the character of a spatial dimension (that is, there can be local variations or “warps”). More recently, time travel stories have incorporated features of quantum theory: phenomena such as superposition and entanglement suggest the possibility of parallel or many universes, many minds, or many histories. Indeed, the sometimes counter-intuitive principles and effects of quantum theory have invigorated time travel stories. Bizarre phenomena like negative energy density (the Casimir effect) lend their strangeness to the already odd character of time travel stories.

In this article, we make a distinction between time travel stories that might be possible within the canon of known physical laws and those stories that contravene or go beyond known laws. The former type of stories, which we shall call natural time travel, exploit the features or natural topology of spacetime regions. Natural time travel tends to severely constrain the activities of a time traveler and entails immense technological challenges. The latter type of stories, which we shall call Wellsian time travel, enable the time traveler more freedom and simplify the technological challenges, but at the expense of the physics. For example, in H. G. Wells’ story, the narrator is a time traveler who constructs a machine that transports him through time. The time traveler’s journey, as he experiences it, occurs over some nonzero duration of time. Also, the journey is through some different nonzero duration of time in the world. It is the latter condition that distinguishes the natural time travel story from the Wellsian time travel story. Our laws of physics do not allow travel through a nonzero duration of time in the world (in a sense that will be made clearer below). Wellsian time travel stories are mortgaged on our hope or presumption that more fundamental laws of nature are yet to be discovered beyond the current horizon of scientific knowledge. Natural time travel stories can be analyzed for consistency with known physics while Wellsian time travel stories can be analyzed for consistency with logic. Finally, time travel stories implicate themselves in a constellation of common philosophical problems. Among these philosophically related issues we will address in this article are the metaphysics of time, causality, and personal identity.

2. Definition

What is time travel? One standard definition is that of David Lewis’s: an object time travels iff the difference between its departure and arrival times in the surrounding world does not equal the duration of the journey undergone by the object. This definition applies to both natural and Wellsian time travel. For example, Jane might be a time traveler if she travels for one hour but arrives two hours later in the future (or two hours earlier in the past). In both types of time travel, the times experienced by a time traveler are different from the time undergone by their surrounding world.

But what do we mean by the “time” in time travel? And what do we mean by “travel” in time travel? As the definition for time travel presently stands, we need to clarify what we mean by the word “time” (see the next section). While philosophical analysis of time travel has attended mostly to the difficult issue of time, might there also be vagueness in the word “travel”? Our use of the word “travel” implies two places: an origin and a destination. “I’m going to Morocco,” means “I’m departing from my origination point here and I plan to arrive eventually in Morocco.” But when we are speaking of time travel, where exactly does a time traveler go? The time of origin is plain enough: the time of the time traveler and the time traveler’s surrounding world coincide at the beginning of the journey. But “where” does the time traveler arrive? Are we equivocating in our use of the word ‘travel’ by simply substituting a when for a where? In truth, how do we conceive of a “when”—as a place, a locale, or a region? Different scientific ontologies result in different ideas of what travel through time might be like. Also, different metaphysical concepts of time result in different ideas of what kinds of time travel are possible. It is to the issue of time in philosophy that we now turn.

3. Time in Philosophy

How is time related to existence? Philosophy offers three primary answers to this metaphysical question: eternalism, possibilism, and presentism. The names of these views indicate the ontological status given to time. The eternalist thinks that time, correctly understood, is a fourth dimension essentially constitutive of reality together with space. All times, past, present and future, are actual times just like all points distributed in space are actual points in space. One cannot privilege any one moment in the dimension of time as “more” real than any other moment just like one cannot privilege any point in space as “more” real than any other point. The universe is thus a spacetime “block,” a view that has philosophical roots at least as far back as Parmenides. Everything is one; the appearance of things coming to be and ceasing to be, of time passing or flowing, is simply phenomenal, not real. Objects from the past and future have equal ontological status with present objects. Thus, a presently extinct individual dodo bird exists as equably as a presently existing individual house finch, and the dodo bird and the house finch exist as equably as an individual baby sparrow hatched next Saturday. Whether or not the dodo bird and the baby sparrow are present is irrelevant ontologically; they simply aren’t in our spacetime region right now. The physicist typically views the relation of time to existence in the way that the eternalist does. The life of an object in the universe can be properly shown as:

timetravel1

This diagram shows the spatial movement (in one dimension) of an object through time. The standard depiction of an object’s spacetime “worldline” in Special Relativity, the Minkowski diagram (see below), privileges this block view of the universe. Many Wellsian time travel stories assume the standpoint of eternalism. For example, in Wells’ The Time Machine, the narrator (the time traveler) explains: “There is no difference between Time and any of the three dimensions of Space except that our consciousness moves along it.” Eternalism fits easily into the metaphysics of time travel.

The second view is possibilism, also known as the “growing block” or “growing universe” view. The possibilist thinks that the eternalist’s picture of the universe is correct except for the status of the future. The past and the present are fixed and actual; the future is only possible. Or more precisely, the future of an object holds the possibility of many different worldlines, only one of which will become actual for the object. If eternalism seems overly deterministic, eliminating indeterminacies and human free choice, then possibilism seems to retain some indeterminacy and free choice, at least as far as the future is concerned. For the possibilist, the present takes on a special significance that it does not have for the eternalist. The life of an object according to possibilism might be shown as:

timetravel2

This diagram shows that the object’s worldline is not yet fixed or complete. (It should be pointed out that the necessity of illustrating the time axis with a beginning and end should not be construed as an implicit claim that time itself has a beginning and end.) Some Wellsian time travel stories make use of possibilism. Stories like Back to the Future and Terminator suggest that we can change the outcome of historical events in our world, including our own personal future, through time travel. The many different possible histories of an object introduce other philosophical problems of causation and personal identity, issues that we will consider in greater depth in later sections of the article.

The third view is presentism. The presentist thinks that only temporally present objects are real. Whatever is, exists now. The past was, but exists no longer; the future will be, but does not exist yet. Objects are scattered throughout space but they are not scattered throughout time. Presentists do not think that time is a dimension in the same sense as the three spatial dimensions; they say the block universe view of the eternalists (and the intermediate view of the possibilists) gets the metaphysics of time wrong. If eternalism has its philosophical roots in Parmenides, then presentism can be understood as having its philosophical roots in Heraclitus. Presently existing things are the only actuality and only what is now is real. Each “now” is unique: “You cannot step twice into the same river; for fresh waters are ever flowing in upon you.” The life of an object according to presentism might be shown as:

timetravel3

Many presentists account for the continuity of time, the timelike connection of one moment to the next moment, by appealing to the present intrinsic properties of the world (Bigelow). To fully describe some of these present intrinsic properties of the world, you need past- and future-tensed truths to supervene on those properties. For example, in ordinary language we might make the claim that “George Washington camped at Valley Forge.” This sentence has an implicit claim to a timeless truth, that is, it was true 500 years ago, it was true when it was happening, it is true now, and it will be true next month. But, according to presentism, only presently existing things are real. Thus, the proper way to understand the truth of this sentence is to translate it into a more primitive form, where the tense is captured by an operator. So in our example, the truth of the sentence supervenes on the present according to the formulation “WAS(George Washington camps at Valley Forge).” In this way, presentists can describe events in the past and future as truths that supervene on the present. It is the basis for their account of persistence through time in issues like causality and personal identity.

4. Time in Physics

Since the use of the term ‘time’ in our definition of time travel remains ambiguous, we may further distinguish external, or physical time from personal, or inner time (again, following Lewis). In the ordinary world, external time and one’s personal time coincide with one another. In the world of the time traveler, they do not. So, with these two senses of time, we may further clarify time travel to occur when the duration of the journey according to the personal time of the time traveler does not equal the duration of the journey in external time. Most (but not all) philosophy of time concerns external time (see the encyclopedia entry Time). For the purpose of natural time travel, we need to examine the scientific understanding of external time and how it has changed.

a. Newtonian Cosmology

Newton argued that space, time and motion were absolute, that is, that the entire universe was a single, uniform inertial frame and that time passed equably throughout it according to an eternally fixed, immutable and inexorable rate, without relation to anything external. Natural time travel in the Newtonian universe is impossible; there are no attributes or topography of space or time that can be exploited for natural time travel stories. Only time travel stories that exceed the bounds of Newtonian physics are possible and scenarios described by some Wellsian time travel stories (most notably like the one Wells himself wrote) are examples of such unscientific time travel.

Several philosophers and scientists objected to the notion of absolute space, time and motion, most notably Leibniz, Berkeley and Mach. Mach rejected Newton’s implication that there was anything substantive about time: “It is utterly beyond our power to measure the changes of things by time. Quite the contrary, time is an abstraction, at which we arrive by means of the changes of things” (The Science of Mechanics, 1883). For Mach, change was more fundamental than the concept of time. We talk about time “passing” but what we’re really noticing is that things move and change around us. We find it convenient to talk as if there were some underlying flowing substance like the water of a river that carries these changes along with it. We abstract time to have a standard measuring tool by which we can quantify change. These views of Mach’s were influential for the young Albert Einstein. In 1905, Einstein published his famous paper on Special Relativity. This theory began the transformation of our understanding of space, time and motion.

b. Special Relativity

The theory of Special Relativity has two defining principles: the principle of relativity and the invariance of the speed of light. Briefly, the principle of relativity states that the laws of physics are the same for any inertial observer. An observer is an inertial observer if the observer’s trajectory has a constant velocity and therefore is not under the influence of any force. The second principle is the invariance of the speed of light. All inertial observers measure the speed c of light in a vacuum as 3 x 10⁸ m/s, regardless of their velocities relative to one another. This principle was implied in Maxwell’s equations of electromagnetism (1873) and the constancy of c was verified by the Michelson-Morley interferometer experiment (1887).

This second principle profoundly affected the model of the cosmos: the constancy of c was inconsistent with Newtonian physics. The invariance of the speed of light according to Special Relativity replaces the invariance of time and distance in the Newtonian universe. Intervals of space, like length, and intervals of time (and hence, motion) are no longer absolute quantities. Instead of speaking of an object in a particular position independently of a particular time, we now speak of an event in which position and time are inseparable. We can relate two events with a new quantity, the spacetime interval. For any pair of events, the spacetime interval is an absolute quantity (that is, has the same value) for all inertial observers. To visualize this new quantity, one constructs spacetime diagrams (Minkowski diagrams) in which an event is defined by its spatial position (usually restricted to one dimension, x) and its time (ct). Thus, a spacetime interval might be null (parallel to the trajectory of light, which, because of the y-axis units, is shown at a 45° angle), spacelike (little or no variation in time), or timelike (little or no variation in spatial position). The following figure shows a Minkowski diagram depicting the flat spacetime of Special Relativity and three different spacetime intervals, or worldlines.

timetravel4

What are the consequences of Special Relativity for time travel? First, we lose the common sense meaning of simultaneity. For example, the same event happens at two different times if one observer’s inertial frame is stationary relative to another observer’s inertial frame moving at some velocity. Furthermore, an observer in the stationary inertial frame may determine two events to have happened simultaneously, but an observer in the second moving inertial frame would see the same two events happening at different times. Thus, there is no universal or absolute external time; we can only speak of external time within one’s own frame of reference. The lack of simultaneity across frames of reference means that we might experience the phenomenon of time dilation. If your frame of reference is moving at some fraction of the speed of light, your external time passes more slowly than the external time in a frame of reference that is stationary relative to yours. If we imagine that someone in the stationary frame of reference could peek at a clock in your frame of reference, they would see your clock run very slowly. So in Special Relativity, we can find a kind of natural time travel. An example of Special Relativity time travel is of an astronaut who travels some distance in the universe at a velocity near the speed of light. The astronaut’s personal time elapses at the same rate it always has. He travels to his destination and then returns home to find that external time has passed there quite differently. Everyone he knew has aged more than he, or perhaps has even been dead for hundreds or thousands of years.

Such stories are physically consistent with the Einsteinian universe of Special Relativity, but of course they remain technologically beyond our present capability. Nevertheless, they are an example of a natural time travel story—adhering to the known laws of physics—which do not require exceptions to fundamental scientific principles (for example, the invariant and inviolable speed of light). But as a time travel story, they require that the time traveler also be an ordinary traveler, too, that is, that he travel some distance through space at extraordinary speeds. Furthermore, this sort of natural time traveler can only time travel into the future. (Conversely, from the perspective of those in the originating frame of reference, when the astronaut returns, they witness the effects of time travel to the past perhaps because they have a person present among them who was alive in their distant past.) So natural time travel according to Special Relativity is perhaps too limited for what we normally mean by time travel since it requires (considerable) spatial travel in order to work.

In addition, there are other limitations, not least of which is mass-energy equivalence. This principle was published by Einstein in his second paper of 1905, entitled “Does the Inertia of a Body Depend Upon Its Energy Content?” Mass-energy equivalence was implied by certain consequences of Special Relativity (other theorists later discovered that it was suggested by Maxwell’s electromagnetism theory). Mass-energy equivalence is expressed by the famous formula, E = mc². It means that there is an energy equivalent to the mass of a particle at rest. When we harmonize mass-energy equivalence with the conservation law of energy, we find that if a mass ceases to exist, its equivalent amount of energy must appear in some form. Mass is interchangeable with energy. Now only mass-less objects, like photons, can actually move at the speed of light. They have kinetic energy but no mass energy. Indeed, all objects with mass at rest, like people and spaceships cannot, in principle, attain the speed of light. They would require an infinite amount of energy.

c. General Relativity

In Special Relativity, all inertial frames are equivalent, and while this is a useful approximation, it does not yet suggest how inertial frames are to be explained. Mach had stated that the distribution of matter determines space and time. But how? This was the question answered by Einstein in his theory of General Relativity (1916). Special Relativity is actually a subset of General Relativity. General Relativity takes into account accelerating frames of reference (that is, non-inertial frames) and thus, the phenomenon of gravity. The topography of spacetime is created by the distribution of mass. Spacetime is dynamic, it curves, and matter “tells” a region of spacetime how to curve. Likewise, the resultant geometry of a spacetime region determines the motion of matter in it.

The fundamental principle in General Relativity is the equivalence principle, which states that gravity and acceleration are two names designating the same phenomenon. If you are accelerating upwards at a rate g in an elevator located in a region of spacetime without a gravitational field, the force you would feel and the motion of objects in the elevator with you would be indistinguishable from an elevator that is stationary within a downward uniform gravitational field of magnitude g. To be more precise, there is no “force” of gravity. When we observe astronauts who are in orbit over the Earth, it is not true to say that they are in an environment with no gravity. Rather, they are in free fall within the Earth’s gravitational field. They are in a local inertial frame and thus do not feel the weight of their own mass.

One curious effect of General Relativity is that light bends when it travels near objects. This may seem strange when we remember that light has no mass. How can light be affected by gravity? Light always travels in straight lines. Light bends because the geometry of spacetime is non-Euclidean in the vicinity of any mass. The curved path of light around a massive body is only apparent; it is simply traveling a geodesic straight line. If we draw the path of an airplane traveling the shortest international route in only two dimensions (like on a flat map), the path appears curved; however, because the earth itself is curved and not flat, the shortest distance, a straight line, must always follow a geodesic path. Light travels along the straight path through the various contours of spacetime. Another curious effect of General Relativity is that gravity affects time. Imagine a uniformly accelerating frame, like a rocket during an engine burn. General Relativity predicts that, depending on one’s location in the rocket, one will measure time differently. To an observer at the bottom or back of the rocket (depending on how you want to visualize its motion), a clock at the top or front of the rocket will appear to run faster. According to the principle of equivalence, then, a clock at sea level on the Earth runs a little slower than a clock at the top of Mount Everest because the strength of the field is weaker the further you are from the center of mass.

Are natural time travel stories possible in General Relativity? Yes, they are, and some of them are quite curious. While most of spacetime seems to be flat or gently rolling contours, physicists are aware of spacetime regions with unusual and severe topologies such as rotating black holes. Black holes are entities that remain from the complete collapse of stars. Black holes are the triumph of gravity over all other forces and are predicted by a solution to Einstein’s General Relativity equations (Kerr, 1963). When they rotate, the singularity of the black hole creates a ring or torus, which might be traversable (unlike the static black hole, whose singularity would be an impenetrable point). If an intrepid astronaut were to position herself near the horizon of the rapidly spinning center of a black hole (without falling into its center and possibly being annihilated), she would be treated to a most remarkable form of time travel. In a brief period of her personal time she would witness an immensely long time span in the universe beyond the black hole horizon; her spacetime region would be so far removed from the external time of the surrounding cosmos that she conceivably could witness thousands, millions, or billions of years elapse. This is a kind of natural time travel; however, it severely restricts the activity of the astronaut/time traveler and she is limited to “travel” into the future. Are there solutions to General Relativity that allow natural time travel into the past? Yes, but unlike rotating black holes, they remain only theoretical possibilities.

Einstein’s neighbor in Princeton, Kurt Gödel, developed one such solution. In 1949, Gödel discovered that some worldlines in closed spacetime could curve so severely that they curved back onto themselves, forming a loop in spacetime. These loops are known as closed timelike curves (CTCs). If you were an object on a CTC worldline, you would eventually arrive at the same spacetime position from which you started, that is, your older self would appear at one of its own earlier spacetime points. Gödel’s CTC spacetime describes a rotating universe; thus, it is an extreme case for a CTC because it is globally intrinsic to the structure of the universe. It is not considered a realistic solution since current cosmological theory states that the universe is expanding, not rotating.

One type of spacetime region that a natural time traveler might exploit is a wormhole: two black holes whose throats are linked by a tunnel. Wormholes would connect two regions of space and two regions of time as well. Physicist Kip Thorne speculated that if one could trap one of the black holes that comprise the mouths of the wormhole it would be conceivable to transport it, preferably at speeds near the speed of light. The moving black hole would age more slowly than the stationary black hole at the other end of the wormhole because of time dilation. Eventually, the two black holes would become unsynchronized and exist in different external times. The natural time traveler could then enter the stationary black hole and emerge from the wormhole some years earlier than when he departed. Unfortunately for our time traveler, if wormholes exist naturally many scientists think that they are probably quite unstable (particularly if quantum effects are taken into account). So, any natural wormhole would require augmentation from exotic phenomena like negative energy in order to be useful as a time machine.

Another type of CTC suggested by Gott (1991) employs two infinitely long and very fast moving cosmic “strings” of extremely dense material. The atom-width strings would have to travel parallel to one another in opposite directions. As they rush past one another, they would create severely curved spacetime such that spacetime curved back on itself. The natural time traveler would be prepared to exploit these conditions at just the right moment and fly her spaceship around the two strings. If executed properly, she would return to her starting point in space but at an earlier time.

One common feature of all CTCs, whether it is the global Gödelian rotating universe or the local regions of rolled-up spacetime around a wormhole or cosmic strings, is that they are solutions to General Relativity that would describe CTCs as already built into the universe. The natural time traveler would have to seek out these structures through ordinary travel and then exploit them. So far, we are not aware of any solution to General Relativity that describes the evolution of a CTC in a spacetime region where time travel had not been possible previously; however, it is usually assumed that there are such solutions to the equations. These solutions would entail particular physical constraints. One constraint would be the creation of a singularity in a finite region of spacetime. To enter the region where time travel might be possible, one would have to cross the Cauchy horizon, the hourglass-shaped (for two crossing cosmic strings) boundary of the singularity in which the laws of physics are unknown. Were such a CTC constructed, a second constraint would limit the external time that would be accessible to the time traveler. You could not travel to a time prior to the inception date of the CTC. (For more on this sort of time travel, see Earman, Smeenk, and Wüthrich, 2002.)

Natural time travel according to General Relativity faces daunting technological challenges especially if you want to have some control over the trajectory of your worldline. One problem already mentioned is that of stability. But equally imposing is the problem of energy. Fantastic amounts of exotic matter (or structures and conditions similar to the early moments of the Big Bang, like membranes with negative tension boundary layers, or gravitational vacuum polarization) would be needed to construct and manage a usable wormhole; infinitely long tubes of hyperdense matter would be needed for cosmic strings. Despite these technological challenges, it should be pointed out that the possibility of natural time travel into the past is consistent with General Relativity. But Hawking and other physicists recognize another problem with actual time travel into the past along CTCs: maintaining a physically consistent history within causal loops (see Causation below). One advantage of some interpretations of relativistic quantum theory is that the logical requirement for a consistent history in a time travel story is seemingly avoided by postulating alternative histories (or worlds) instead of one history of the universe.

d. Quantum Interpretations

Certain aspects of quantum theory are relevant to time travel, in particular the field of quantum gravity. The fundamental forces of nature (strong nuclear force, electromagnetic force, weak nuclear force, and gravitation) have relativistic quantum descriptions; however, attempts to incorporate gravity in quantum theory have been unsuccessful to date. On the current standard model of the atom, all forces are carried by “virtual” particles called gauge bosons (corresponding to the order given above for the forces: mesons and gluons, photons, massive W and Z particles, and the hypothetical graviton). A physicist might say that the photon “carries” electromagnetic force between “real” particles. The graviton, which has eluded attempts to detect it, “carries” gravity. This particle-characterization of gravity in quantum theory is very different from Einstein’s geometrical characterization in General Relativity. Reconciling these two descriptions is a robust area of research and many hope that gravity can be understood in the same way as the other fundamental forces. This might eventually lead to the formulation of a “theory of everything.”

Scientists have proposed several interpretations of quantum theory. The central issue in interpretations of quantum theory is entanglement. When two quantum systems enter into temporary physical interaction, mutually influencing one another through known forces, and then separate, the two systems cannot be described again in the same way as when they were first brought together. Microstate and macrostate entanglement occurs when an observer measures some physical property, like spin, with some instrumentation. The rule, according to the orthodox (or Copenhagen) interpretation, is that when observed the state vector (the equation describing the entangled system) reduces or jumps from a state of superposition to one of the actually observed states. But what happens when an entangled state “collapses?” The orthodox interpretation states that we don’t know; all we can say about it is to describe the observed effects, which is what the wave equation or state vector does.

Other interpretations claim that that the state vector does not “collapse” at all. Instead, some no-collapse interpretations claim that all possible outcomes of the superposition of states become real outcomes in one way or another. In the many-worlds version of this interpretation (Everett, 1957), at each such event the universe that involves the entangled state exfoliates into identical copies of the universe, save for the values of the properties included in the formerly entangled state vector. Thus, at any given moment of “collapse” there exist two or more nearly identical universes, mutually unobservable yet equally real, that then each divide further as more and more entangled events evolve. On this view, it is conceivable that you were both born and not born, depending on which world we’re referring to; indeed, the meaning of ‘world’ becomes problematic. The many universes are collectively designated as the multiverse. There are other variations on the many-worlds interpretation, including the many minds version (Albert and Loewer, 1988) and the many histories version (Gell-Mann and Hartle, 1989); however, they all share the central claim that the state vector does not “collapse.”

Many natural time travel stories make use of these many-worlds conceptions. Some scientists and storytellers speculate that if we were able to travel through a wormhole that we would not be traversing a spacetime interval in our own universe, but instead we would be hopping from “our” universe to an alternative universe. A natural time traveler in a many-worlds universe would, upon their return trip, enter a different world history. This possibility has become quite common in Wellsian time travel stories, for example, in Back to the Future and Terminator. These types of stories suggest that through time travel we can change the outcome of historical events in our world. The idea that the history of the universe can be changed is why many of the inconsistencies with causation and personal identity arise. We now turn to these topics to examine the philosophical implications of time travel stories.

5. Causation

Inconsistencies and incoherence in time travel stories often result from spurious applications of causation. Causation describes the connected continuity of events that change. The nature of this relation between events, for example, whether it is objective or subjective, is a subject of debate in philosophy. But for our purposes, we need only notice that events generally appear to have causes. The distinction made between external and personal time is crucial now for the difficulties of causation in some time travel stories.

Imagine Heloise is a time traveler who travels 80 years in the past to visit Harold. They have a fight and Heloise knocks out one of Harold’s teeth. If we follow the progression of Heloise’s personal time (or of Harold’s), the story is consistent; indeed, time travel seems to have little effect upon the events described. The difficulty arises when we test the consistency of the story in external time, because it involves an earlier event being affected by a later event. The ordinary forward progress of events related to Harold 80 years ago requires a schism in the connectivity and continuity of those events to allow the entry of a later event, namely, Heloise’s time travel journey. The activity of Heloise is causally continuous with respect to her personal time but not with respect to external time (assuming that the continuity of her personal identity is not in question, as we shall discuss in the next section). With respect to external time, this story describes reversed causation, for later events produce changes in earlier events. How does the story change if Heloise is homicidal and encounters her own grandfather 80 years ago? This is a scenario many think show that time travel into the past is inconsistent and thus impossible.

a. The Grandfather Paradox

Heloise despises her paternal grandfather. Heloise is homicidal and has been trained in various lethal combat techniques. Despite her relish at the thought of murdering her grandfather, time has conspired against her, for her grandfather has been dead for 30 years. As a crime investigator might say, she has motive and means, but lacks the opportunity; that is, until she fortuitously comes into the possession of a time machine. Now Heloise has the opportunity to fulfill her desire. She makes the necessary settings on the machine and plunges back into time 80 years. She emerges from the machine and begins to stalk her grandfather. He suspects nothing. She waits for the perfect moment and place to strike so that she can enjoy the full satisfaction of her hatred. At this point, we might pause to observe: “If Heloise murders her grandfather, she will have prevented him from fathering any children. That means that Heloise’s own father will not be born. And that means that Heloise will not be born. But if she never comes into existence, then how is she able to return…?” And so we have the infamous grandfather paradox. Before we examine what happens next, let’s consider the possible outcomes of her impending action.

First, let’s assume that the many-worlds hypothesis correctly describes the universe. If so, then we avoid the paradox. If Heloise succeeds in killing her grandfather before her father is conceived, then the state of the world includes quantum entanglement of the events involved in Heloise’s mind, body, surrounding objects, etc., such that when she succeeds in killing her grandfather (or willing his death just prior to the physical accomplishment of it), the universe at that moment divides into one universe in which she succeeded and a second universe in which she did not. So the paradox of causal continuity in external time does not arise; causation presumably connects events in the different universes without any inconsistency. But as we shall see in the next section this quantum interpretation trades-off a causation paradox for a personal identity paradox.

Next, let’s assume that we do not have the many-worlds quantum interpretation available to us, nor for that matter, any theory of different worlds. Can Heloise murder her grandfather? As David Lewis famously remarked, in one sense she can, and in another sense she can’t. The sense in which she can murder her grandfather refers to her ability, her willingness, and her opportunity to do so. But the sense in which she cannot murder her grandfather trumps the sense in which she can. In fact, she does not murder her grandfather because the moments of external time that have already passed are no longer separable. Assuming that events 80 years ago did not include Heloise murdering her grandfather, she cannot create another moment 80 years ago that does. A set of facts is arranged such that it is perfectly appropriate to say that, in one sense, Heloise can murder her grandfather. However, this set of facts is enclosed by the larger set of facts that include the survival of her grandfather. Were Heloise to actually succeed in carrying out her murderous desire, this larger set of facts would contain a contradiction (that her grandfather both is murdered and is not murdered 80 years ago), which is impossible. History remains consistent.

This is also related to Stephen Hawking’s view (1992). According to his so-called Chronology Protection Conjecture, he claims that the laws of physics conspire to prevent macroscopic inconsistencies like the grandfather paradox. A “Chronology Protection Agency” works through events like vacuum fluctuations or virtual particles to prevent closed trajectories of spacetime curvature in the negative direction (CTCs). If Hawking is right and many-worlds quantum interpretations are not available, then is time travel to the past still possible? Hawking’s view about consistent history then takes us to the special case of causation paradoxes: the causal loop.

b. Causal Loops

A causal loop is a chain of causes that closes back on itself. A causes B, which causes C,…which causes X, which causes A, which causes B…and so on ad infinitum. This sequence of events is exploited in some natural and Wellsian time travel stories. It is a point of debate whether all time travel stories involving travel to the past include causal loops. As we have seen, causal loops can occur when extraordinary cosmic structures curve spacetime in a negative direction. Wellsian time travel stories with causal loops describe scenarios like the following one by Keller and Nelson (2001).

Jennifer, a young teenager, is visited by an old woman who materializes in her bedroom. The old woman describes intimate details that only Jennifer would know and thus convinces Jennifer to pursue a professional tennis career. Jennifer does exactly as the old woman suggested and eventually retires, successful and happy. One day she comes into the possession of a time machine and decides to use it to travel back in time so that she might try to make her teenage years happier. Jennifer travels back into the past and stands before a person she recognizes as her younger self. Jennifer begins to talk to the teenager about her hidden talents and the bright future before her as a tennis professional. At the end of their conversation, Jennifer activates the time machine and returns to her original time. We can describe the causal loop in Keller and Nelson’s story as follows. The story contained within in the causal loop is presented on the left side. At event C, the story splits, with the causal loop continuing along C1, and the exit from the loop beginning at C2. At C2, the worldline of Jennifer continues outside the causal loop events. Thus:

timetravel5

The events of Jennifer’s life include a causal loop: some of those events have no beginning and no end. What is the problem with the story? Each moment of the causal sequence is explicable in terms of the prior events. But where (or when) did the crucial information that Jennifer would have a successful tennis career come from originally? While each part of the causal sequence makes sense, the causal loop as a whole is surprising because it includes information ex nihilo. It is controversial whether such uncaused causes are possible. Some philosophers (for example, Mellor, 1998) think that causal loop time travel stories are impossible because causal loops are themselves impossible. They argue that time and causality must progress in the same direction. Other philosophers (for example, Horwich, 1987) argue that while causal loops are not impossible, they are highly implausible, and thus spacetime does not permit time travel into the “local” past (like one’s own life) because fantastic amounts of energy would be required. Still other philosophers (for example, Lewis) think that causal loops are possible because at least some events, like the Big Bang, appear to be events without causes, introducing information ex nihilo.

According to Hawking, causal loop stories that employ CTCs are like grandfather paradox stories. While backwards causation might be logically possible, it is not physically possible. The “Chronology Protection Agency” actively prevents them from occurring. The laws of physics conspire such that natural time travel into the past thwarts backwards or reverse causation. In closed spacetime, the Cauchy horizon of a CTC acts as an impenetrable barrier to a timelike worldline for objects. If a time traveler could travel to the past, whether or not that past included their younger self, they are prevented from interacting with the events of the past.

If causal loops are possible, then the objects may interact with the events of the past, but only in a consistent way, that is, only in a way that preserves the already established events of the past. Perhaps we could call it the CTC prime directive (see Ray Bradbury’s short story “A Sound of Thunder”). Causal loops, like any other aporia of uncaused causes, occupy the inexplicable perimeter of philosophical thought about causation. Nevertheless, causal loop stories like that of Jennifer raise another issue: personal identity.

6. Personal Identity

The old Jennifer travels back in time to talk with her younger self. Are there two Jennifers or just one Jennifer at event A? At the same moment in external time, a young Jennifer and an old Jennifer are separated by a distance of a few feet. At that moment, is there one person or two? Identity theory involves the relationships between the mind and the body that attempts to show the connection between mental states and physical states (see the entry Personal Identity). It tries, for example, to describe and explain the connection (if any) between mind and the brain. For Lewis, the mental/physical distinction is crucial for explaining how a time traveler like Jennifer is one person, even when she travels back to talk with her younger self. Our cognitions change according to the requirement of causal continuity. These mental states occur in personal time. For everyday purposes, we can ignore the distinction between personal time and external time; personal time and external time coincide. But for a time traveler like Jennifer, identity is maintained only by virtue of the traveler’s personal time; their mental states continue like anyone else’s and at any given point in personal time, later mental states do not cause earlier ones.

In the case of Jennifer, it is therefore proper to say that at event A in her life, there is only one person, even though it is also true to say from an external perspective, that she has two different bodies present at event A. Lewis’s distinction between the sense in which you can and the sense in which you can’t has its coda in the subject of personal identity. In the sense of personal time, Jennifer is one person who is perceiving another person (from either Jennifer’s perspective). The older Jennifer’s materialization into the presence of the younger Jennifer is strange, to be sure, but in a time travel story, it is explicable. Regardless, in her personal time, the causal continuity of her perception (and thus mental states) is consistent. In the sense of external time, from the perspective of their surrounding world, there are two Jennifers at event A. The mental state of the younger Jennifer is not identical to the mental state of the older Jennifer. But these mental states, these stages of Jennifer’s life are not duplicates of the same stage; rather, two moments of personal time overlap at one moment of external time. So is it still proper to say that there are two of her? Lewis argues no, it is not. In the strange case of a time traveler like Jennifer, her stages are scattered in such a way that they do not connect in a continuously forward direction through external time, but they do connect continuously forward through her personal time. The time traveler who meets up with her younger self gives the appearance to an outside observer that she is two different people, but in reality, there is only one person.

The question of how objects persist through time is the subject of the endurance and perdurance debate in philosophy. An endurantist is someone who thinks that objects are wholly present at each moment of an interval of time. A perdurantist is someone who thinks that objects only have a temporal part present at each moment of an interval of time. The perdurantist claims that the identity of the whole object is identified as the sum of these temporal parts over the lifetime of the object. It seems that it is impossible for an endurantist to believe the story about Jennifer because she would have to be wholly present in two different spatial locations at the same time. The endurantist can avoid this problem by appealing to the distinction between personal time and external time. If Jennifer is wholly present at different locations “at the same time,” which kind of time do we mean? We mean external time. The endurantist can claim that two different temporal stages in her personal time just so happen to coincide because she is a time traveler at different locations at a single moment of external time. For those of us who are not time travelers, our different temporal stages are also distinct moments in external time. But in either case, whether time traveler or not, a person is wholly present at any moment of their personal time.

The perdurantist seems to have an easier way with the problem of personal identity in time travel stories. Since a person is only partially present at each moment of external time, it is readily conceivable that different temporal parts might coincide, but we still need to appeal to the distinction between personal time and external time. The two temporal parts of Jennifer’s life that occur when the young and old Jennifer meet and have a conversation are each elements among many others that in toto form the whole person.

Personal identity is especially problematic in a many-worlds hypothesis. Consider the case of Heloise and her desire to murder her grandfather. According to the many-worlds hypothesis, she travels back in time but by doing so also skips into another universe. Heloise is free to kill her grandfather because she would not be killing “her” grandfather, that is, the same grandfather that she knew about before her time travel journey. Indeed, Heloise herself may have split into two different persons. Whatever she does after she travels into the past would be consistent with the history of the alternative universe. But the question of who exactly Heloise or her grandfather is becomes problematic, especially if we assume that her actions in the different universes are physically distinct. Is Heloise the sum of her appearances in the many worlds? Or is each appearance of Heloise a unique person?

Also, see the related article Time in this Encyclopedia.

7. References and Further Reading

Albert, David and Barry Loewer. 1988. Interpreting the many worlds interpretation. Synthese 77:195-213.
Bigelow, John. Time travel fiction. In Gerhard Preyer and Frank Siebelt, eds., Reality and Humean Supervenience. Lanham, MD: Rowan & Littlefield, 2001. 58-91.
Bigelow, John. Presentism and properties. In James E. Tomberlin, ed., Philosophical Perspectives 10. Cambridge, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 1996. 35-52.
Bradbury, Ray. 1952. A Sound of Thunder. In R is for Rocket. New York: Doubleday.
Earman, John. 1995. Outlawing Time Machines: chronology protection theorems. Erkenntnis 42(2):125-139.
Earman, John, Smeenk, Christopher and Wüthrich, Christian. 2002. Take a ride on a time machine. In R. Jones and P. Ehrlich, eds., Reverberations of the Shaky Game: Festschrift for Arthur Fine. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Everett, Hugh. 1957. Relative state formulation of quantum mechanics. Review of Modern Physics 29:454-62.
Gell-Mann, Murray and James B. Hartle. 1989. Quantum mechanics in the light of quantum cosmology. In Proceedings of the 3rd International Symposium on the Foundations of Quantum Mechanics. Tokyo, Japan. 321-43.
Gott, J. Richard. Time Travel in Einstein’s Universe: The Physical Possibilities of Travel Through Time. Boston: Houghton Mifflin, 2001.
Hawking, S. W. 1992. Chronology protection conjecture. Physical Review D 46(2):603-11.
Horwich, Paul. 1987. Asymmetries in Time: Problems in the Philosophy of Science. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Keller, Simon and Michael Nelson. 2001. Presentists should believe in time-travel. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 79:333-45.
Lewis, David. 1976. The paradoxes of time travel. American Philosophical Quarterly 13:145-52.
Mellor, D. H. Real Time II. London: Routledge, 1998.
Monton, Bradley. 2003. Presentists can believe in closed timelike curves. Analysis 63(3).
Smith, Nicholas J. J. 1997. Bananas enough for time travel? British Journal of Philosophy 48:363-389.

Author Information

Joel Hunter
Email: jhunter@tmcc.edu
Truckee Meadows Community College
U. S. A.

Thales of Miletus (c. 620 B.C.E.—c. 546 B.C.E.)

thales The ancient Greek philosopher Thales was born in Miletus in Greek Ionia. Aristotle, the major source for Thales’s philosophy and science, identified Thales as the first person to investigate the basic principles, the question of the originating substances of matter and, therefore, as the founder of the school of natural philosophy. Thales was interested in almost everything, investigating almost all areas of knowledge, philosophy, history, science, mathematics, engineering, geography, and politics. He proposed theories to explain many of the events of nature, the primary substance, the support of the earth, and the cause of change. Thales was much involved in the problems of astronomy and provided a number of explanations of cosmological events which traditionally involved supernatural entities. His questioning approach to the understanding of heavenly phenomena was the beginning of Greek astronomy. Thales’ hypotheses were new and bold, and in freeing phenomena from godly intervention, he paved the way towards scientific endeavor. He founded the Milesian school of natural philosophy, developed the scientific method, and initiated the first Western enlightenment. Many anecdotes are closely connected to Thales’ investigations of the cosmos. When considered in association with his hypotheses they take on added meaning and are most enlightening. Thales was highly esteemed in ancient times, and a letter cited by Diogenes Laertius, and purporting to be from Anaximenes to Pythagoras, advised that all our discourse should begin with a reference to Thales (D.L. II.4).

The Writings of Thales
Possible Sources for Aristotle
Thales says Water is the Primary Principle
Thales and Mythology
Thales’s Primary Principle
New Ideas about the Earth
All Things are Full of God
Thales’s Astronomy
Mathematics
1. The Theorems Attributed to Thales
Crossing the Halys
The Possible Travels of Thales
The Milesian School
The Seven Sages of Ancient Greece
Corner in Oil
The Heritage of Thales
References and Further Reading
Abbreviations

1. The Writings of Thales

Doubts have always existed about whether Thales wrote anything, but a number of ancient reports credit him with writings. Simplicius (Diels, Dox. p. 475) specifically attributed to Thales authorship of the so-called Nautical Star-guide. Diogenes Laertius raised doubts about authenticity, but wrote that ‘according to others [Thales] wrote nothing but two treatises, one On the Solstice and one On the Equinox‘ (D.L. I.23). Lobon of Argus asserted that the writings of Thales amounted to two hundred lines (D.L. I.34), and Plutarch associated Thales with opinions and accounts expressed in verse (Plutarch, De Pyth. or. 18. 402 E). Hesychius, recorded that ‘[Thales] wrote on celestial matters in epic verse, on the equinox, and much else’ (DK, 11A2). Callimachus credited Thales with the sage advice that navigators should navigate by Ursa Minor (D.L. I.23), advice which may have been in writing.

Diogenes mentions a poet, Choerilus, who declared that ‘[Thales] was the first to maintain the immortality of the soul’ (D.L. I.24), and in De Anima, Aristotle’s words ‘from what is recorded about [Thales]’, indicate that Aristotle was working from a written source. Diogenes recorded that ‘[Thales] seems by some accounts to have been the first to study astronomy, the first to predict eclipses of the sun and to fix the solstices; so Eudemus in his History of Astronomy. It was this which gained for him the admiration of Xenophanes and Herodotus and the notice of Heraclitus and Democritus’ (D.L. I.23). Eudemus who wrote a History of Astronomy, and also on geometry and theology, must be considered as a possible source for the hypotheses of Thales. The information provided by Diogenes is the sort of material which he would have included in his History of Astronomy, and it is possible that the titles On the Solstice, and On the Equinox were available to Eudemus. Xenophanes, Herodotus, Heraclitus and Democritus were familiar with the work of Thales, and may have had a work by Thales available to them.

Proclus recorded that Thales was followed by a great wealth of geometers, most of whom remain as honoured names. They commence with Mamercus, who was a pupil of Thales, and include Hippias of Elis, Pythagoras, Anaxagoras, Eudoxus of Cnidus, Philippus of Mende, Euclid, and Eudemus, a friend of Aristotle, who wrote histories of arithmetic, of astronomy, and of geometry, and many lesser known names. It is possible that writings of Thales were available to some of these men.

Any records which Thales may have kept would have been an advantage in his own work. This is especially true of mathematics, of the dates and times determined when fixing the solstices, the positions of stars, and in financial transactions. It is difficult to believe that Thales would not have written down the information he had gathered in his travels, particularly the geometry he investigated in Egypt and his measuring of the height of the pyramid, his hypotheses about nature, and the cause of change.

Proclus acknowledged Thales as the discoverer of a number of specific theorems (A Commentary on the First Book of Euclid’s Elements 65. 8-9; 250. 16-17). This suggests that Eudemus, Proclus’s source had before him the written records of Thales’s discoveries. How did Thales ‘prove’ his theorems if not in written words and sketches? The works On the Solstice, On the Equinox, which were attributed to Thales (D.L. I.23), and the ‘Nautical Star-guide, to which Simplicius referred, may have been sources for the History of Astronomy of Eudemus (D.L. I.23).

2. Possible Sources for Aristotle

There is no direct evidence that any written material of Thales was available to Plato and Aristotle, but there is a surprisingly long list of early writers who could have known Thales, or had access to his works, and these must be considered as possible sources for Plato, Aristotle, and the philosophers and commentators who followed them. Aristotle’s wording, ‘Thales says’, is assertive wording which suggests a reliable source, perhaps writings of Thales himself. Anaximander and Anaximenes were associates of Thales, and would have been familiar with his ideas. Both produced written work. Anaximander wrote in a poetical style (Theophr. ap. Simpl. Phys. fr. 2), and the writing of Anaximenes was simple and unaffected (D.L. II.3). Other philosophers who were credited with written works, who worked on topics similar to those of Thales, and who may have provided material for later writers, are Heraclitus of Ephesus, Anaxagoras of Clazomenae, Alcmaeon, Hippo of Samos, and Hippias of Elis.

3. Thales says Water is the Primary Principle

Aristotle defined wisdom as knowledge of certain principles and causes (Metaph. 982 a2-3). He commenced his investigation of the wisdom of the philosophers who preceded him, with Thales, the first philosopher, and described Thales as the founder of natural philosophy (Metaph. 983 b21-22). He recorded: ‘Thales says that it is water’. ‘it’ is the nature, the archê, the originating principle. For Thales, this nature was a single material substance, water. Despite the more advanced terminology which Aristotle and Plato had created, Aristotle recorded the doctrines of Thales in terms which were available to Thales in the sixth century B.C.E., Aristotle made a definite statement, and presented it with confidence. It was only when Aristotle attempted to provide the reasons for the opinions that Thales held, and for the theories that he proposed, that he sometimes displayed caution.

4. Thales and Mythology

Those who believe that Thales inherited his views from Greek or Near-Eastern sources are wrong. Thales was esteemed in his times as an original thinker, and one who broke with tradition and not as one who conveyed existing mythologies. Aristotle unequivocally recorded Thales’s hypothesis on the nature of matter, and proffered a number of conjectures based on observation in favour of Thales’s declaration (Metaph. 983 b20-28). His report provided the testimony that Thales supplanted myth in his explanations of the behaviour of natural phenomena. Thales did not derive his thesis from either Greek or non-Greek mythological traditions.

Thales would have been familiar with Homer’s acknowledgements of divine progenitors but he never attributed organization or control of the cosmos to the gods. Aristotle recognized the similarity between Thales’s doctrine about water and the ancient legend which associates water with Oceanus and Tethys, but he reported that Thales declared water to be the nature of all things. Aristotle pointed to a similarity to traditional beliefs, not a dependency upon them. Aristotle did not call Thales a theologian in the sense in which he designated ‘the old poets’ (Metaph. 1091 b4) and others, such as Pherecydes, as ‘mixed theologians’ who did not use ‘mythical language throughout’ (Metaph. 1091 b9). To Aristotle, the theories of Thales were so obviously different from all that had gone before that they stood out from earlier explanations. Thales’s views were not ancient and primitive. They were new and exciting, and the genesis of scientific conjecture about natural phenomena. It was the view for which Aristotle acknowledged Thales as the founder of natural philosophy.

5. Thales’s Primary Principle

The problem of the nature of matter, and its transformation into the myriad things of which the universe is made, engaged the natural philosophers, commencing with Thales. For his hypothesis to be credible, it was essential that he could explain how all things could come into being from water, and return ultimately to the originating material. It is inherent in Thales’s hypotheses that water had the potentiality to change to the myriad things of which the universe is made, the botanical, physiological, meteorological and geological states. In Timaeus, 49B-C, Plato had Timaeus relate a cyclic process. The passage commences with ‘that which we now call “water” ‘, and describes a theory which was possibly that of Thales. Thales would have recognized evaporation, and have been familiar with traditional views, such as the nutritive capacity of mist and ancient theories about spontaneous generation, phenomena which he may have ‘observed’, just as Aristotle believed he, himself had (Hist. An. 569 b1; Gen. An. 762 a9-763 a34), and about which Diodorus Siculus (I.7.3-5; 1.10.6), Epicurus (ap. Censorinus, D.N. IV.9), Lucretius (De Rerum Natura , V.783-808) and Ovid (Met. I.416-437) wrote.

When Aristotle reported Thales’s pronouncement that the primary principle is water, he made a precise statement: ‘Thales says that it [the nature of things] is water’ (Metaph. 983 b20), but he became tentative when he proposed reasons which might have justified Thales’s decision: ‘[Thales’s] supposition may have arisen from observation . . . ‘ (Metaph. 983 b22). It was Aristotle’s opinion that Thales may have observed, ‘that the nurture of all creatures is moist, and that warmth itself is generated from moisture and lives by it; and that from which all things come to be is their first principle’ (Metaph. 983 b23-25). Then, in the lines 983 b26-27, Aristotle’s tone changed towards greater confidence. He declared: ‘Besides this, another reason for the supposition would be that the semina of all things have a moist nature . . . ‘ (Metaph. 983 b26-27). In continuing the criticism of Thales, Aristotle wrote: ‘That from which all things come to be is their first principle’ (Metaph. 983 b25).

Simple metallurgy had been practised long before Thales presented his hypotheses, so Thales knew that heat could return metals to a liquid state. Water exhibits sensible changes more obviously than any of the other so-called elements, and can readily be observed in the three states of liquid, vapour and ice. The understanding that water could generate into earth is basic to Thales’s watery thesis. At Miletus it could readily be observed that water had the capacity to thicken into earth. Miletus stood on the Gulf of Lade through which the Maeander river emptied its waters. Within living memory, older Milesians had witnessed the island of Lade increasing in size within the Gulf, and the river banks encroaching into the river to such an extent that at Priene, across the gulf from Miletus the warehouses had to be rebuilt closer to the water’s edge. The ruins of the once prosperous city-port of Miletus are now ten kilometres distant from the coast and the Island of Lade now forms part of a rich agricultural plain. There would have been opportunity to observe other areas where earth generated from water, for example, the deltas of the Halys, the Ister, about which Hesiod wrote (Theogony, 341), now called the Danube, the Tigris-Euphrates, and almost certainly the Nile. This coming-into-being of land would have provided substantiation of Thales’s doctrine. To Thales water held the potentialities for the nourishment and generation of the entire cosmos. Aëtius attributed to Thales the concept that ‘even the very fire of the sun and the stars, and indeed the cosmos itself is nourished by evaporation of the waters’ (Aëtius, Placita, I.3).

It is not known how Thales explained his watery thesis, but Aristotle believed that the reasons he proposed were probably the persuasive factors in Thales’s considerations. Thales gave no role to the Olympian gods. Belief in generation of earth from water was not proven to be wrong until A.D. 1769 following experiments of Antoine Lavoisier, and spontaneous generation was not disproved until the nineteenth century as a result of the work of Louis Pasteur.

6. New Ideas about the Earth

Thales proposed answers to a number of questions about the earth: the question of its support; its shape; its size; and the cause of earthquakes; the dates of the solstices; the size of the sun and moon.

a. The Earth Floats on Water

In De Caelo Aristotle wrote: ‘This [opinion that the earth rests on water] is the most ancient explanation which has come down to us, and is attributed to Thales of Miletus (Cael. 294 a28-30). He explained his theory by adding the analogy that the earth is at rest because it is of the nature of wood and similar substances which have the capacity to float on water, although not on air (Cael. 294 a30-b1). In Metaphysics (983 b21) Aristotle stated, quite unequivocally: ‘Thales . . . declared that the earth rests on water’. This concept does appear to be at odds with natural expectations, and Aristotle expressed his difficulty with Thales’s theory (Cael. 294 a33-294 b6).

Perhaps Thales anticipated problems with acceptance because he explained that it floated because of a particular quality, a quality of buoyancy similar to that of wood. At the busy city-port of Miletus, Thales had unlimited opportunities to observe the arrival and departure of ships with their heavier-than-water cargoes, and recognized an analogy to floating logs. Thales may have envisaged some quality, common to ships and earth, a quality of ‘floatiness’, or buoyancy. It seems that Thales’s hypothesis was substantiated by sound observation and reasoned considerations. Indeed, Seneca reported that Thales had land supported by water and carried along like a boat (Sen. QNat. III.14). Aristotle’s lines in Metaphysics indicate his understanding that Thales believed that, because water was the permanent entity, the earth floats on water.

Thales may have reasoned that as a modification of water, earth must be the lighter substance, and floating islands do exist. Herodotus (The Histories, II.156) was impressed when he saw Chemmis, a floating island, about thirty-eight kilometres north-east of Naucratis, the Egyptian trading concession which Thales probably visited. Seneca described floating islands in Lydia: ‘There are many light, pumice-like stones of which islands are composed, namely those which float in Lydia’ (Sen. QNat., III.25. 7-10). Pliny described several floating islands, the most relevant being the Reed Islands, in Lydia (HN, II.XCVII), and Pliny (the Younger) (Ep. VIII.XX) described a circular floating island, its buoyancy, and the way it moved. Thales could have visited the near-by Reed Islands. He might have considered such readily visible examples to be models of his theory, and he could well have claimed that the observation that certain islands had the capacity to float substantiated his hypothesis that water has the capacity to support earth.

Again it is understood that Thales did not mention any of the gods who were traditionally associated with the simple bodies; we do not hear of Oceanus or Gaia: we read of water and earth. The idea that Thales would have resurrected the gods is quite contrary to the bold, new, non-mythical theories which Thales proposed.

b. Thales’s Spherical Earth

Modern commentators assume that Thales regarded the earth as flat, thin, and circular, but there is no ancient testimony to support that opinion. On the contrary, Aristotle may have attributed knowledge of the sphericity of the earth to Thales, an opinion which was later reported by Aëtius (Aët. III. 9-10) and followed by Ps.-Plutarch (Epit. III.10). Aristotle wrote that some think it spherical, others flat and shaped like a drum (Arist. Cael. 293 b33-294 a1), and then attributed belief in a flat earth to Anaximenes, Anaxagoras, and Democritus (Arist. Cael. 294 b14-15). If following chronological order, Aristotle’s words, ‘some think it spherical’, referred to the theory of Thales. Aristotle then followed with the theory of Thales’s immediate Milesian successor, Anaximander, and then reported the flat earth view of Anaximenes, the third of the Milesian natural philosophers.

There are several good reasons to accept that Thales envisaged the earth as spherical. Aristotle used these arguments to support his own view (Arist. Cael. 297 b25-298 a8). First is the fact that during a solar eclipse, the shadow caused by the interposition of the earth between the sun and the moon is always convex; therefore the earth must be spherical. In other words, if the earth were a flat disk, the shadow cast during an eclipse would be elliptical. Second, Thales, who is acknowledged as an observer of the heavens, would have observed that stars which are visible in a certain locality may not be visible further to the north or south, a phenomena which could be explained within the understanding of a spherical earth. Third, from mere observation the earth has the appearance of being curved. From observation, it appears that the earth is covered by a dome. When observed from an elevated site, the sky seems to surround the earth, like a dome, to meet the apparently curved horizon. If observed over the seasons, the dome would appear to revolve, with many of the heavenly bodies changing their position in varying degrees, but returning annually to a similar place in the heavens. Through his work in astronomy Thales would almost certainly have become familiar with the night sky and the motion of the heavenly bodies. There is evidence that he gave advice to navigate by Ursa Minor, and was so involved in observation of the stars that he fell into a well. As a result of observations made over a long period of time, Thales could have realized that the motions of the fixed stars could not be explained within the idea of the observable hemispherical dome. During the determination of the size of the rising sun, and again while watching its risings and settings during his work on fixing the solstices, Thales may have realized that much natural phenomena could be explained only within the understanding of the earth as a sphere.

From the shore, a ship can be seen to be descending, gradually, below the horizon, with the hull disappearing from view first, to be followed by masts and sails. If one had a companion observing from a higher point, the companion would see the ship for a long period before it disappeared from view.

Aëtius recorded the different opinions of the shape of the earth that were held by Thales, Anaximander and Anaximenes (III.9-10; III.10; and III.10). Cicero attributed to Thales the earliest construction of a solid celestial globe (Rep. I.XIII.22). Thales’s immediate successors proposed theories about the shape of the earth which were quite different from each other, but that is no reason to reject the view that Thales hypothesized a spherical earth. It is not the only occasion on which Anaximander and Anaximenes failed to follow the theories of Thales. That they did not do so is the main argument in favour of accepting that the scientific method commenced in the Milesian School. There is testimony that Thales knew the earth to be spherical, but no evidence to suggest that he proposed any other shape.

c. Earthquake Theory

Thales’s theory about the cause of earthquakes is consistent with his hypothesis that earth floats upon water. It seems that he applied his floating on water simile to the natural phenomena of earthquakes. Aëtius recorded that Thales and Democritus found in water the cause of earthquakes (Aët. III.15), and Seneca attributed to Thales a theory that on the occasions when the earth is said to quake it is fluctuating because of the roughness of oceans (QNat. III.14; 6.6). Although the theory is wrong, Thales’s hypothesis is rational because it provides an explanation which does not invoke hidden entities. It is an advance upon the traditional Homeric view that they resulted from an angry supernatural god, Poseidon, shaking the earth through his rapid striding.

7. All Things are Full of God

The question of whether Thales endowed the gods with a role in his theories is fundamental to his hypotheses. The relevant text from Aristotle reads: ‘Thales, too, to judge from what is recorded of his views, seems to suppose that the soul is in a sense the cause of movement, since he says that a stone [magnet, or lodestone] has a soul because it causes movement to iron’ (De An. 405 a20-22); ‘Some think that the soul pervades the whole universe, whence perhaps came Thales’s view that everything is full of gods’ (De An. 411 a7-8). In reference to the clause in the first passage ‘to judge from what is recorded of his views’, Snell convincingly argued that Aristotle had before him the actual sentence recording Thales’s views about the lodestone (Snell, 1944, 170). In the second passage the ‘some’ to whom Aristotle refers are Leucippus, Democritus, Diogenes of Apollonia, Heraclitus, and Alcmaeon, philosophers who were later than Thales. They adopted and adapted the earlier view of Thales that soul was the cause of motion, permeating and enlivening the entire cosmos. The order in which Aristotle discussed Thales’s hypothesis obscures the issue.

The source for Aristotle’s report that Thales held all things to be full of gods is unknown, but some presume that it was Plato. Thales is not mentioned in the relevant lines in Plato, but there is a popular misconception that they refer to the belief of Thales. This is wrong. Thales had rejected the old gods. In a passage in Apology(26 C) Socrates identified the heavenly bodies as gods, and pointed out that that was the general understanding. In Cratylus(399 D-E) Plato had Socrates explain a relationship between soul as a life-giving force, the capacity to breathe, and the reviving force. In Timaeus 34B) Plato had Timaeus relate a theory which described soul as pervading the whole universe. Then, in Laws Plato has the Athenian Stranger say: ‘Everyone . . . who has not reached the utmost verge of folly is bound to regard the soul as a god. Concerning all the stars and the moon, and concerning the years and months and all seasons, what other account shall we give than this very same, – namely, that, inasmuch as it has been shown that they are all caused by one or more souls . . . we shall declare these souls to be gods . . .? Is there any man that agrees with this view who will stand hearing it denied that ‘all things are full of gods’? The response is: ‘No man is so wrong-headed as that’ (Laws, 899 A-B). Plato had the Athenian Stranger extend his ideas into a theological theory. He used a sleight of hand method to express his own ideas about divine spiritual beings. With the exception of gods in the scheme of things, these passages reflect the beliefs which formed the Thalean hypothesis, but Plato did not have the Athenian Stranger attribute the crucial clause ‘all things are full of gods’ to Thales. Thales is not mentioned.

Aristotle’s text not the earliest extant testimony. Diogenes preserved a report from Hippias: ‘Aristotle and Hippias affirm that, arguing from the magnet and from amber, [Thales] attributed a soul or life even to inanimate objects’ (D.L. I.24). This early report does not mention godly entities. The later commentators, Cicero (Nat. D. I.X.25), and Stobaeus (Ecl. I.1.11) included gods in Thales’s theory. However, their views post-date Stoicism and are distorted by theistic doctrines.

Plato converted the idea of soul into a theory that ‘all things are full of gods’, and this may have been Aristotle’s source, but the idea of gods is contrary to Thales’s materialism. When Thales defined reality, he chose an element, not a god. The motive force was not a supernatural being. It was a force within the universe itself. Thales never invoked a power that was not present in nature itself, because he believed that he had recognized a force which underpinned the events of nature.

8. Thales’s Astronomy

a. The Eclipse of Thales

Thales is acclaimed for having predicted an eclipse of the sun which occurred on 28 May 585 B.C.E. The earliest extant account of the eclipse is from Herodotus: ‘On one occasion [the Medes and the Lydians] had an unexpected battle in the dark, an event which occurred after five years of indecisive warfare: the two armies had already engaged and the fight was in progress, when day was suddenly turned into night. This change from daylight to darkness had been foretold to the Ionians by Thales of Miletus, who fixed the date for it within the limits of the year in which it did, in fact, take place’ (Hdt. I.74). The vital points are: Thales foretold a solar eclipse; it did occur within the period he specified. How Thales foretold the eclipse is not known but there is strong opinion that he was able to perform this remarkable feat through knowledge of a cycle known as the Saros, with some attributing his success to use of the Exeligmos cycle. It is not known how Thales was able to predict the Eclipse, if indeed he did, but he could not have predicted the Eclipse by using the Saros or the Exeligmos cycles.

In addition to Herodotus, the successful prediction of the eclipse was accepted by Eudemus in his History of Astronomy and acknowledged by a number of other writers of ancient times (Cicero, Pliny, Dercyllides, Clement, Eusebius). This is how Diogenes Laertius recorded the event: ‘[Thales] seems by some accounts to have been the first to study astronomy, the first to predict eclipses of the sun, and to fix the solstices; so Eudemus in his History of Astronomy. It was this which gained for him the admiration of Xenophanes and Herodotus and the notice of Heraclitus and Democritus’ (D.L. I.23). Diogenes asserted that Herodotus knew of Thales’s work, and in naming Xenophanes, Heraclitus, and Democritus, he nominated three of the great pre-Socratics, eminent philosophers who were familiar with the work of Thales.

Modern astronomy confirms that the eclipse did occur, and was total. According to Herodotus’s report, the umbra of the eclipse of Thales must have passed over the battle field. The “un-naturalness” of a solar eclipse is eerie and chilling. All becomes hushed and there is a strong uncanny sensation of impending disaster, of being within the control of some awful power. In ancient times, the awesome phenomenon must have aroused great fear, anxiety and wonder. The combatants saw the eclipse as disapproval of their warfare, and as a warning. They ceased fighting and a peace agreement was reached between the two kings.

It is not known why Thales turned away from the traditional beliefs which attributed all natural events and man’s fortunes and misfortunes to the great family of Olympian gods, but Miletus was the most prosperous of the Ionian cities, and it cannot be doubted that the flourishing merchants believed that their prosperity resulted from their own initiative and endeavours. Thales’s great philosophical pronouncement that water is the basic principle shows that Thales gave no acknowledgement to the gods as instigators and controllers of phenomena. Thales’s hypotheses indicate that he envisaged phenomena as natural events with natural causes and possible of explanation. From his new perspective of observation and reasoning, Thales studied the heavens and sought explanations of heavenly phenomena.

It is widely accepted that Thales acquired information from Near-Eastern sources and gained access to the extensive records which dated from the time of Nabonassar (747 B.C.E.) and which were later used by Ptolemy (Alm. III.7. H 254). Some commentators have suggested that Thales predicted the solar eclipse of 585 B.C.E. through knowledge of the Saros period, a cycle of 223 lunar months (18 years, 10-11 days plus 0.321124 of a day) after which eclipses both of the sun and moon repeat themselves with very little change, or through knowledge of the Exeligmos cycle which is exactly three times the length of the Saros (Ptolemy, Alm. IV.2. H270). The ancients could not have predicted solar eclipses on the basis of those periodic cycles because eclipses of the sun do not repeat themselves with very little change. The extra 0.321124 of a day means that each recurring solar eclipse will be visible to the west, just under one-third of the circumference of the earth, being a period of time of almost 7.7 hours. This regression to the west could not have been known to the ancient astrologers, a fact which seems not to have been taken into account by the philosophers who attribute Thales’s success to application of one of those two cycles.

The following important fact should be noted. Some commentators and philosophers believe that Thales may have witnessed the solar eclipse of 18th May 603 B.C.E. or have had heard of it. They accepted that he had predicted the solar eclipse of 28 May 585 B.C.E. and reasoned from the astronomical fact of the Saros cycles and the fact that the two solar eclipses had been separated by the period of 18 years, 10 days, and 7.7 hours, and concluded that Thales had been able to predict a solar eclipse based upon the knowledge of that cycle. Two facts discount rebut those claims. First, recent research shows that the solar eclipse of 18th May 603 B.C.E. would not have been visible in Egypt, nor in the Babylonian observation cities where the astronomers watched the heavens for expected and unusual heavenly events. The eclipse of 603 passed over the Persian Gulf, too far to the south for observation (Stephenson, personal communication, March 1999; and Stephenson, “Long-term Fluctuations”, 165-202). Even if the eclipse of 603 had been visible to the Near-Eastern astronomers, it is not possible to recognize a pattern from witnessing one event, or indeed, from witnessing two events. One may suggest a pattern after witnessing three events that are separated by equal periods of time, but the eclipse which preceded that of 603, and which occurred on 6th May 621, was not visible in Near-Eastern regions. Consequently, it could not have been recorded by the astrologer/priests who watched for unusual heavenly phenomena, and could not have been seen as forming a pattern.

It is quite wrong to say that eclipses repeat themselves with very little change, because each solar eclipse in a particular Saros occurs about 7.7 hours later than in the previous eclipse in the same Saros, and that is about ¹/₃ of the circumference of the earth’s circumference. Adding to the difficulty of recognizing a particular cycle is the fact that about forty-two periodic cycles are in progress continuously, and overlapping at any time. Every series in a periodic cycle lasts about 1,300 years and comprises 73 eclipses. Eclipses which occur in one periodic cycle are unrelated to eclipses in other periodic cycles.

The ancient letters prove that the Babylonians and Assyrians knew that lunar eclipses can occur only at full moon, and solar eclipses only at new moon, and also that eclipses occur at intervals of five or six months. However, while lunar eclipses are visible over about half the globe, solar eclipses are visible from only small areas of the earth’s surface. Recent opinion is that, as early as 650 B.C.E. the Assyrian astronomers seem to have recognized the six months-five months period by which they could isolate eclipse possibilities (Steele, “Eclipse Prediction”, 429).

In other recent research Britton has analysed a text known as Text S, which provides considerable detail and fine analysis of lunar phenomena dating from Nabonassar in 747 B.C.E. The text points to knowledge of the six-month five month periods. Britton believes that the Saros cycle was known before 525 B.C.E. (Britton, “Scientific Astronomy”, 62) but, although the text identifies a particular Saros cycle, and graphically depicts the number of eclipse possibilities, the ancient commentary of Text S does not attest to an actual observation (Britton, “An Early Function”, 32).

There is no evidence that the Saros could have been used for the prediction of solar eclipses in the sixth century B.C.E., but it remains possible that forthcoming research, and the transliteration of more of the vast stock of ancient tablets will prove that the Babylonians and Assyrians had a greater knowledge of eclipse phenomena than is now known.

The Babylonian and Assyrian astronomers knew of the Saros period in relation to lunar eclipses, and had some success in predicting lunar eclipses but, in the sixth century B.C.E. when Thales lived and worked, neither the Saros nor the Exeligmos cycles could be used to predict solar eclipses.

It is testified that Thales knew that the sun is eclipsed when the moon passes in front of it, the day of eclipse – called the thirtieth by some, new moon by others (The Oxyrhynchus Papyri, 3710). Aëtius (II.28) recorded: [Thales] says that eclipses of the sun take place when the moon passes across it in a direct line, since the moon is earthy in character; and it seems to the eye to be laid on the disc of the sun’.

There is a possibility that, through analysis of ancient eclipse records, Thales identified another cycle, the lunar eclipse-solar eclipse cycle of 23 ¹/₂ months, the fact that a solar eclipse is a possibility 23 ¹/₂ months after a lunar eclipse. However, lunar eclipses are not always followed by solar eclipses. Although the possibility is about 57% it is important to note that the total solar eclipse of 28th May, 585, occurred 23 ¹/₂months after the total lunar eclipse of 4th July, 587. The wording of the report of the eclipse by Herodotus: ‘Thales . . . fixed the date for the eclipse within the limits of the year’ is precise, and suggests that Thales’s prediction was based upon a definite eclipse theory.

b. Setting the Solstices

A report from Theon of Smyrna ap. Dercyllides states that: ‘Eudemus relates in the Astronomy that Thales was the first to discover the eclipse of the sun and that its period with respect to the solstices is not always constant’ (DK, 11 A 17). Diogenes Laertius (I.24) recorded that [Thales] was the first to determine the sun’s course from solstice to solstice, and also acknowledged the Astronomy of Eudemus as his source.

Solstices are natural phenomena which occur on June 21 or 22, and December 21 or 22, but the determination of the precise date on which they occur is difficult. This is because the sun seems to ‘stand still’ for several days because there is no discernible difference in its position in the sky. It is the reason why the precise determination of the solstices was so difficult. It was a problem which engaged the early astronomers, and more than seven centuries later, Ptolemy acknowledged the difficulty (Alm. III.1. H203).

It is not known how Thales proceeded with his determination, but the testimony of Flavius Philostratus is that: ‘[Thales] observed the heavenly bodies . . . from [Mount] Mycale which was close by his home’ (Philostratus, Life of Apollonius , II.V). This suggests that Thales observed the rising and setting of the sun for many days at mid-summer and mid-winter (and, necessarily, over many years). Mount Mycale, being the highest point in the locality of Miletus, would provide the perfect vantage point from which to make observations. Another method which Thales could have employed was to measure the length of the noon-day sun around mid-summer and mid-winter. Again this would require observations to be made, and records kept over many days near the solstice period, and over many years.

c. Thales’s Discovery of the Seasons

From Diogenes Laertius we have the report: ‘[Thales] is said to have discovered the seasons of the year and divided it into 365 days’ (D.L. I.27). Because Thales had determined the solstices, he would have known of the number of days between say, summer solstices, and therefore have known the length of a solar year. It is consistent with his determination of the solstices that he should be credited with discovering that 365 days comprise a year. It is also a fact that had long been known to the Egyptians who set their year by the more reliable indicator of the annual rising of the star Sirius in July. Thales may have first gained the knowledge of the length of the year from the Egyptians, and perhaps have attempted to clarify the matter by using a different procedure. Thales certainly did not ‘discover’ the seasons, but he may have identified the relationship between the solstices, the changing position during the year of the sun in the sky, and associated this with seasonal climatic changes.

d. Thales’s Determination of the Diameters of the Sun and the Moon

Apuleius wrote that ‘Thales in his declining years devised a marvellous calculation about the sun, showing how often the sun measures by its own size the circle which it describes’. (Apul. Florida, 18). Following soon after Apuleius, Cleomedes explained that the calculation could be made by running a water-clock, from which the result was obtained: the diameter of the sun is found to be one seven-hundred-and-fiftieth of its own orbit (Cleomedes, De Motu circulari corporum caelestium, II.75). The third report is from Diogenes: ‘According to some [Thales was] the first to declare the size of the sun to be one seven hundred and twentieth part of the solar circle, and the size of the moon to be the same fraction of the lunar circle’ (D.L. I.24). Little credence can be given to the water-clock method for reaching this determination, because there is an inbuilt likelihood of repeated errors over the 24 hour period. Even Ptolemy, who flourished in the second century A.D., rejected all measurements which were made by means of water-clocks, because of the impossibility of attaining accuracy by such means (Alm. V.14. H416).

In his work in geometry, Thales was engaged in circles and angles, and their characteristics, and he could have arrived at his solution to the problem by applying the geometrical knowledge he had acquired. There is no evidence to support a suggestion that Thales was familiar with measurements by degrees but he could have learnt, from the Babylonians, that a circle is divided into 3600. The figure of 720, which was given by Diogenes for Thales, is double 360, and this is related to the Babylonian sexagesimal system. To establish the dates of the solstices, Thales probably made repeated observations of the risings and settings of the sun. From such experiments he could have observed that the angle which was subtended by the elevation of the rising sun is 1/20 and with 3600 in a circle, the ratio of 1:720 is determined.

Of the report from Diogenes Laertius (D.L. I.24) that Thales also determined the orbit of the moon in relation to the size of its diameter, Thales would repeat the method to calculate the orbit of the moon.

e. Ursa Minor

Callimachus (D.L. I.22) reported that Thales ‘discovered’ Ursa Minor. This means only that he recognized the advantages of navigating by Ursa Minor, rather than by Ursa Major, as was the preferred method of the Greeks. Ursa Minor, a constellation of six stars, has a smaller orbit than does the Great Bear, which means that, as it circles the North Pole, Ursa Minor changes its position in the sky to a lesser degree than does the Great Bear. Thales offered this sage advice to the mariners of Miletus, to whom it should have been of special value because Miletus had developed a maritime trade of economic importance.

f. Falling into a Well

In Theaetetus (174 A) Plato had Socrates relate a story that Thales was so intent upon watching the stars that he failed to watch where he was walking, and fell into a well. The story is also related by Hippolytus (Diels, Dox. 555), and by Diogenes Laertius (D.L. II.4-5). Irony and jest abound in Plato’s writing and he loved to make fun of the pre-Socratics, but he is not likely to have invented the episode, especially as he had Socrates relate the event. Aristotle wrote that viewing the heavens through a tube ‘enables one to see further’ (Gen. An. 780 b19-21), and Pliny (HN, II.XI) wrote that: ‘The sun’s radiance makes the fixed stars invisible in daytime, although they are shining as much as in the night, which becomes manifest at a solar eclipse and also when the star is reflected in a very deep well’. Thales was renowned and admired for his astronomical studies, and he was credited with the ‘discovery’ of Ursa Minor (D.L. I.23). If Thales had heard that stars could be viewed to greater advantage from wells, either during day or night, he would surely have made an opportunity to test the theory, and to take advantage of a method that could assist him in his observations. The possibility that the story was based on fact should not be overlooked. Plato had information which associated Thales with stars, a well, and an accident. Whether Thales fell into a well, or tripped when he was getting in or out of a well, the story grew up around a mishap.

9. Mathematics

The practical skill of land measurement was invented in Egypt because of the necessity frequently to remeasure plots of land after destructive inundations. The phenomena is well described by Herodotus (II.93-109). Egypt was believed to be the source of much wisdom and reports tell us that many Greeks, including Thales, Pythagoras, Solon, Herodotus, Plato, Democritus, and Euclid, visited that ancient land to see the wonders for themselves.

The Egyptians had little to offer in the way of abstract thought. The surveyors were able to measure and to calculate and they had outstanding practical skills. In Egypt Thales would have observed the land surveyors, those who used a knotted cord to make their measurements, and were known as rope-stretchers. Egyptian mathematics had already reached its heights when The Rhind Mathematical Papyrus was written in about 1800 B.C.E. More than a thousand years later, Thales would have watched the surveyors as they went about their work in the same manner, measuring the land with the aid of a knotted rope which they stretched to measure lengths and to form angles.

The development of geometry is preserved in a work of Proclus, A Commentary on the First Book of Euclid’s Elements (64.12-65.13). Proclus provided a remarkable amount of intriguing information, the vital points of which are the following: Geometry originated in Egypt where it developed out of necessity; it was adopted by Thales who had visited Egypt, and was introduced into Greece by him

The Commentary of Proclus indicates that he had access to the work of Euclid and also to The History of Geometry which was written by Eudemus of Rhodes, a pupil of Aristotle, but which is no longer extant. His wording makes it clear that he was familiar with the views of those writers who had earlier written about the origin of geometry. He affirmed the earlier views that the rudiments of geometry developed in Egypt because of the need to re-define the boundaries, just as Herodotus stated.

a. The Theorems Attributed to Thales

Five Euclidean theorems have been explicitly attributed to Thales, and the testimony is that Thales successfully applied two theorems to the solution of practical problems.

Thales did not formulate proofs in the formal sense. What Thales did was to put forward certain propositions which, it seems, he could have ‘proven’ by induction: he observed the similar results of his calculations: he showed by repeated experiment that his propositions and theorems were correct, and if none of his calculations resulted in contrary outcomes, he probably felt justified in accepting his results as proof. Thalean ‘proof’ was often really inductive demonstration. The process Thales used was the method of exhaustion. This seems to be the evidence from Proclus who declared that Thales ‘attacked some problems in a general way and others more empirically’.

DEFINITION I.17: A diameter of the circle is a straight line drawn through the centre and terminated in both directions by the circumference of the circle; and such a straight line also bisects the circle (Proclus, 124). >

PROPOSITION I.5: In isosceles triangles the angles at the base are equal; and if the equal straight lines are produced further, the angles under the base will be equal (Proclus, 244). It seems that Thales discovered only the first part of this theorem for Proclus reported: We are indebted to old Thales for the discovery of this and many other theorems. For he, it is said, was the first to notice and assert that in every isosceles the angles at the base are equal, though in somewhat archaic fashion he called the equal angles similar (Proclus, 250.18-251.2).

PROPOSITION I.15: ‘If two straight lines cut one another, they make the vertical angles equal to one another’ (Proclus, 298.12-13). This theorem is positively attributed to Thales. Proof of the theorem dates from the Elements of Euclid (Proclus, 299.2-5).

PROPOSITION I.26: ‘If two triangles have the two angles equal to two angles respectively, and one side equal to one side, namely, either the side adjoining the equal angles, or that subtending one of the equal angles, they will also have the remaining sides equal to the remaining sides and the remaining angle equal to the remaining angle’ (Proclus, 347.13-16). ‘Eudemus in his history of geometry attributes the theorem itself to Thales, saying that the method by which he is reported to have determined the distance of ships at sea shows that he must have used it’ (Proclus, 352.12-15). Thales applied this theorem to determine the height of a pyramid. The great pyramid was already over two thousand years old when Thales visited Gizeh, but its height was not known. Diogenes recorded that ‘Hieronymus informs us that [Thales] measured the height of the pyramids by the shadow they cast, taking the observation at the hour when our shadow is of the same length as ourselves’ (D.L. I.27). Pliny (HN, XXXVI.XVII.82) and Plutarch (Conv. sept. sap. 147) also recorded versions of the event. Thales was alerted by the similarity of the two triangles, the ‘quality of proportionality’. He introduced the concept of ratio, and recognized its application as a general principle. Thales’s accomplishment of measuring the height of the pyramid is a beautiful piece of mathematics. It is considered that the general principle in Euclid I.26 was applied to the ship at sea problem, would have general application to other distant objects or land features which posed difficulties in the calculation of their distances.

PROPOSITION III.31: ‘The angle in a semicircle is a right angle’. Diogenes Laertius (I.27) recorded: ‘Pamphila states that, having learnt geometry from the Egyptians, [Thales] was the first to inscribe a right-angled triangle in a circle, whereupon he sacrificed an ox’. Aristotle was intrigued by the fact that the angle in a semi-circle is always right. In two works, he asked the question: ‘Why is the angle in a semicircle always a right angle?’ (An. Post. 94 a27-33; Metaph. 1051 a28). Aristotle described the conditions which are necessary if the conclusion is to hold, but did not add anything that assists with this problem.

It is testified that it was from Egypt that Thales acquired the rudiments of geometry. However, the evidence is that the Egyptian skills were in orientation, measurement, and calculation. Thales’s unique ability was with the characteristics of lines, angles and circles. He recognized, noticed and apprehended certain principles which he probably ‘proved’ through repeated demonstration.

10. Crossing the Halys

Herodotus recorded ‘the general belief of the Greeks’ that Thales assisted Croesus in transporting his troops across the Halys river (Hdt. I.75) on his advance into Capadoccia to engage the great Persian conqueror, Cyrus who threatened from the east. Herodotus provided a detailed description of the reported crossing which many of the Greeks supposed had been accomplished through Thales’s engineering skills and ingenuity (Hdt. I.75). Herodotus had been told that Thales advised Croesus to divide the river into two parts. The story is that Thales directed the digging so that the river was diverted into two smaller streams, each of which could then be forded. The story from Herodotus describes a formation similar to an oxbow lake. The work could have been undertaken by the men of Croesus’s army, and directed by Thales. With both channels then being fordable, Croesus could lead his army across the Halys. This description complies with ‘the general belief of the Greeks’ which Herodotus related.

However, Herodotus did not accept that story, because he believed that bridges crossed the river at that time (I.74). Herodotus’s misgivings were well founded. There is considerable support for the argument that Croesus and his army crossed the Halys by the bridge which already existed and travelled by the Royal Road which provided the main access to the East. Herodotus explained that at the Halys there were gates which had to be passed before one crossed the river, which formed the border, with the post being strongly guarded (Hdt. V.52).

The town of Cesnir Kopru, or Tcheshnir Keupreu, is a feasible site for a crossing. Before the industrialization of the area, a mediaeval bridge was observed, underneath which, when the river was low, could be seen not only the remains of its Roman predecessor but the roughly hewn blocks of a much earlier bridge (Garstang, 1959, 2). Any clues that may have helped to provide an answer to the question of whether there were bridges in the time of Croesus are now submerged by the hydroelectric plants which have been built in the area. Herodotus recorded the details that he had obtained, but used his own different understanding of the situation to discount the report.

11. The Possible Travels of Thales

Establishing whether or not Thales travelled and what countries he visited is important because we may be able to establish what information he could have acquired from other sources. In Epinomis 987 E) Plato made the point that the Greeks took from foreigners what was of value and developed their notions into better ideas.

Eudemus, who was one of Aristotle’s students, believed that Thales had travelled to Egypt (Eudemus ap. Proclus, 65.7). A number of ancient sources support that opinion, including Pamphila who held that he spent time with the Egyptian priests (D.L. I.24), Hieronymus from whose report we learn that Thales measured the height of the pyramids by the shadow they cast (D.L. I.27), and Plutarch (De Is. et Os. 131). Thales gave an explanation for the inundation (D.L. I.37). He may have devised this explanation after witnessing the phenomena, which Herodotus later described (Hdt. II.97).

By 620 B.C.E., and perhaps earlier, Miletus held a trading concession at Naucratis (Hdt. II.178, Strab. 17.1.18) on the Canopic mouth of the Nile, and it is possible that Thales visited Egypt on a trading mission. Travel to Egypt would not have been difficult. Homer had Ulysses sailing from Crete to the Nile in five days, and Ernle Bradford recently made a similar journey, proving the trip to be feasible (Bradford, Ulysses Found, 26, and passim). The wealth of Miletus was the result of its success as a trading centre, and there would have been no difficulty in arranging passage on one of the many vessels which traded through of Miletus.

Josephus (Contra Apionem I.2) wrote that Thales was a disciple of the Egyptians and the Chaldeans which suggests that he visited the Near-East. It is thought that Thales visited the Babylonians and Chaldeans and had access to the astrological records which enabled him to predict the solar eclipse of 585 B.C.E.

Miletus had founded many colonies around the Mediterranean and especially along the coasts of the Black Sea. Pliny (HN, V.31.112) gives the number as ninety. The Milesians traded their goods for raw materials, especially iron and timber, and tunny fish. Strabo made mention of ‘a sheep-industry’, and the yield of ‘soft wool’ (Strabo, 12.3.13), and Aristophanes mentioned the fine and luxurious Milesian wool (Lysistrata, 729; Frogs, 543). The Milesian traders had access to the hinterland. The land around the mouth of the Halys was fertile, ‘productive of everything . . . and planted with olive trees’ (Strabo, 12.3.12-13). Thales was associated with a commercial venture in the production of olive oil in Miletus and Chios, but his interests may have extended beyond those two places. Olive oil was a basic item in the Mediterranean diet, and was probably a trading commodity of some importance to Milesian commerce.

It is likely that Thales was one of the ‘great teachers’ who, according to Herodotus, visited Croesus in the Lydian capital, Sardis (Hdt. I.30). From Sardis, he could have joined a caravan to make the three-month journey along the well used Royal Road (Hdt. V.53), to visit the observatories in Babylonia, and seek the astronomical knowledge which they had accumulated over centuries of observation of heavenly phenomena. In about 547 B.C.E. late in his life, Thales travelled into Cappadocia with Croesus, and, according to some belief, devised a scheme by which the army of Croesus was able to cross the River Halys. Milesian merchantmen continually plied the Black Sea, and gaining a passage could have been easily arranged. From any number of ports Thales could have sought information, and from Sinope he may have ventured on the long journey to Babylonia, perhaps travelling along the valley of the Tigris, as Xenophon did in 401-399 B.C.E.

In a letter purported to be from Thales to Pherecydes, Thales stated that he and Solon had both visited Crete, and Egypt to confer with the priests and astronomers, and all over Hellas and Asia (D.L. I.43-44). All that should be gleaned from such reports, is that travel was not exceptional, with many reports affirming the visits of mainly notable people to foreign lands. Alcaeus visited Egypt’ (Strabo, 1.2.30), and his brother, Antimenidas, served in Judaea in the army of the Babylonian monarch, King Nebuchadrezzar. Sappho went into exile in Sicily, her brother,Charaxus, spent some time in Egypt, and a number of friends of Sappho visited Sardis where they lived in Lydian society. There must have been any number of people who visited foreign lands, about whom we know nothing.

Very little about the travels of Thales may be stated with certainty, but it seems probable that he would have sought information from any sources of knowledge and wisdom, particularly the centres of learning in the Near-East. It is accepted that there was ample opportunity for travel.

12. Milesian School

Thales was the founder of a new school of philosophy (Arist. Metaph. 983 b20). His two fellow Milesians who also engaged in the new questioning approach to the understanding of the universe, were Anaximander, his disciple (D.L. I.13), and Anaximenes, who was the disciple of Anaximander (D.L. II.2). Anaximander was about ten years younger than Thales, but survived him by only a year, dying in about 545. Anaximenes was born in 585 and died in about 528. Their lives all overlapped. Through their association they comprised the Milesian School: They all worked on similar problems, the nature of matter and the nature of change, but they each proposed a different material as the primary principle, which indicates that there was no necessity to follow the master’s teachings or attribute their discoveries to him. Each proposed a different support for the earth. Thales was held in high regard for his wisdom, being acclaimed as the most eminent of the Wise Men of Ancient Greece, but he was not regarded as a god, as Pythagoras was. Anaximander and Anaximenes were free to pursue their own ideas and to express them in writing. This surely suggests that they engaged in critical discussion of the theories of each other. The Greeks are a sociable people, and their willingness to converse brought rewards in knowledge gained, as Plato remarked (Epinomis, 987E). Critical discussion implies more than familiarity with other views, and more than mere disagreement with other theories. It is the adoption, or in this case, the development, of a new style of discussion. It is a procedure which encourages questioning, debate, explanation, justification and criticism. There was a unique relationship between the three Milesians and it is highly probable that the critical method developed in the Milesian School under the leadership of Thales.

13. The Seven Sages of Ancient Greece

The earliest reference to the Seven Sages of Ancient Greece is in Plato’s Protagoras in which he listed seven names: ‘A man’s ability to utter such remarks [notable, short and compressed] is to be ascribed to his perfect education. Such men were Thales of Miletus, Pittacus of Mitylene, Bias of Priene, Solon of our city [Athens], Cleobulus of Lindus, Myson of Chen, and, last of the traditional seven, Chilon of Sparta. . . . and you can recognize that character in their wisdom by the short memorable sayings that fell from each of them’ (Protagoras, 342 E-343 A).

Diogenes recorded that ‘Thales was the first to receive the name of Sage in the archonship of Damasias at Athens, when the term was applied to all the Seven Sages, as Demetrius of Phalerum [born. ca. 350 B.C] mentions in his List of Archons (D.L. I.22). Demetrius cannot have been the source for Plato, who died when Demetrius was only three years old. Perhaps there was a source common to both Plato and Demetrius, but it is unknown.

Damasias was archon in 582/1. It may be significant that at this time the Pythian Games were re-organized. More events were added and, for the first time, they were to be held at intervals of four years, in the third year of the Olympiad, instead of the previous eight-yearly intervals. Whether there is an association between the re-organization of the Pythian Games and the inauguration of the Seven Sages in not known but, as Pausanias indicates, the Seven were selected from all around Greece: ‘These [the sages] were: from Ionia, Thales of Miletus and Bias of Priene; of the Aeolians in Lesbos, Pittacus of Mitylene; of the Dorians in Asia, Cleobulus of Lindus; Solon of Athens and Chilon of Sparta; the seventh sage, according to the list of Plato, the son of Ariston is not Periander, the son of Cypselus, but Myson of Chenae, a village on Mount Oeta’ (Paus. 14.1). The purpose of Damasias may have been aimed at establishing unity between the city-states.

It is difficult to believe that the Seven all assembled at Delphi, although the dates just allow it. Plato wrote that their notable maxims were featured at Delphi: ‘They [the Sages], assembled together and dedicated these [short memorable sayings] as the first-fruits of their lore to Apollo in his Delphic temple, inscribing there those maxims which are on every tongue – “Know thyself’ and “Nothing overmuch” ‘ (Pl. Prt. 343 A-B).

Plato regarded wise maxims as the most essential of the criteria for a sage, and associated them with wisdom and with good education, but he has Socrates say: ‘Think again of all the ingenious devices in arts or other achievements, such as you might expect in one of practical ability; you might remember Thales of Miletus and Anacharsis the Scythian’ (Respublica , 600 A). Practical ability was clearly important.

Several other lists were compiled: Hippobotus (D.L. I.42); Pittacus (D.L. I.42); and Diogenes (D.L. I.13. They omitted some names and adding others. In his work On the Sages, Hermippus reckons seventeen, which included most of the names listed by other compilers.

Many commentators state that Thales was named as Sage because of the practical advice he gave to Miletus in particular, and to Ionia in general. The earlier advice was to his fellow Milesians. In 560, the thirty-five year old Croesus (Hdt. I.25) succeeded his father Alyattes and continued the efforts begun by his father to subdue the Milesians, but without success. Diogenes tells us that ‘when Croesus sent to Miletus offering terms of alliance, [Thales] frustrated the plan’ (D.L. I.25). The second occasion was at an even later date, when the power of Cyrus loomed as a threat from the east. Thales’s advice to the Ionian states was to unite in a political alliance, so that their unified strength could be a defence against the might of Cyrus. This can hardly have been prior to 550 B.C.E. which is thirty years later than the promulgation of the Seven Sages. Thales was not named as a Sage because of any political advice which is extant.

One of the few dates in Thales’s life which can be known with certainty is the date of the Eclipse of 585 B.C.E. It brought to a halt the battle being fought between Alyattes and the Mede, Cyaxares and, in addition, brought peace to the region after ‘five years of indecisive warfare’ (Hdt. I.74). The Greeks believed that Thales had predicted the Eclipse, and perhaps even regarded him as being influential in causing the phenomenon to occur. This was reason enough to declare Thales to be a man of great wisdom and to designate him as the first of the Seven Sages of Ancient Greece.

14. Corner in Oil

Thales’s reputation for wisdom is further enhanced in a story which was related by Aristotle. (Politics, 1259 a 6-23). Somehow, through observation of the heavenly bodies, Thales concluded that there would be a bumper crop of olives. He raised the money to put a deposit on the olive presses of Miletus and Chios, so that when the harvest was ready, he was able to let them out at a rate which brought him considerable profit. In this way, Thales answered those who reproached him for his poverty. As Aristotle points out, the scheme has universal application, being nothing more than a monopoly. There need not have been a bumper harvest for the scheme to have been successful. It is quite likely that Thales was involved in commercial ventures, possibly the export of olive oil, and Plutarch reported that Thales was said to have engaged in trade (Plut. Vit. Sol. II.4).

15. The Heritage of Thales

Thales is the first person about whom we know to propose explanations of natural phenomena which were materialistic rather than mythological or theological. His theories were new, bold, exciting, comprehensible, and possible of explanation. He did not speak in riddles as did Heraclitus, and had no need to invent an undefined non-substance, as Anaximander did. Because he gave no role to mythical beings, Thales’s theories could be refuted. Arguments could be put forward in attempts to discredit them. Thales’s hypotheses were rational and scientific. Aristotle acknowledged Thales as the first philosopher, and criticized his hypotheses in a scientific manner.

The most outstanding aspects of Thales’s heritage are: The search for knowledge for its own sake; the development of the scientific method; the adoption of practical methods and their development into general principles; his curiosity and conjectural approach to the questions of natural phenomena – In the sixth century B.C.E., Thales asked the question, ‘What is the basic material of the cosmos?’ The answer is yet to be discovered.

16. References and Further Reading

Ernle Bradford. Ulysses Found. London: Hodder and Stoughton, 1964.
Britton, John P. “An Early Function for Eclipse Magnitudes in Babylonian Astronomy.” Centaurus, 32 (1989): 32.
Britton, John P. “Scientific Astronomy in Pre-Seleucid Babylon.” Chapter in H.D. Galter, Die Rolle der Astronomy in den Kulteren Mesopotamiens. Graz: 1993.
Garstang, John and O.R. Gurney. The Geography of the Hittite Empire. Occasional Publications of The British Institute of Archaeology in Ankara, no. 5. London: The British Institute of Archaeology at Ankara, 1959.
Proclus. A Commentary on the First Book of Euclid’s Elements. Translated with an Introduction and Notes by Glenn R Morrow. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1970.
Ptolemy. Ptolemy’snAlmagest. Translated and Annotated by G.J. Toomer. London: Duckworth, 1984.
Snell, Bruno. “Die Nachrichten über die Lehren des Thales und die Anfänge der griechischen Philosophie – und Literaturgeschichte.” [The News about the Teachings of Thales and the Beginnings of the Greek History of Philosophy and Literature], Philologus 96 (1944): 170-182.
Steele, John M.”Eclipse Prediction in Mesopotamia.” Archive for History of Exact Science 54 (5) (2000):421-454.
Stephenson, F. Richard, and L.V. Morrison. “Long-term fluctuations in the Earth’s rotation: 700 BC to AD 1990.” Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society of London351 (1995): 165-202.

17. Abbreviations

Aristotle, An. Post., Analytica Posteriora; Cael., De Caelo; De An., De Anima; Gen An., De Generatione Animalium; Hist. An., Historia Animalium; Metaph., Metaphysics; Pol., Politics; Hist. An.; Historia Animalium
Cicero, Rep., De Republica; Nat. D., De Natura Deorum
D.L., Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers
Diels,Dox., H. Diels, Doxographi Graeci
DK, Diels, Hermann and Walther Kranz.Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Zurich: Weidmann, 1985.
Epicurus, ap.Censorinus, D.N.; Censorinus, De die natali
Ovid,Met., Metamorphoses
Plutarch,Plut. De Is. et Os., De Iside et Osiride; De Pyth. or., De Pythiae oraculis; Conv. sept. sap., Convivium septem sapientium, [The Dinner of the Seven Wise Men];; Vit. Sol., Vitae Parallelae, Solon
Pliny (the Elder), HN: Naturalis Historia
Pliny (the Younger), Ep: Epistulae
Ps.-Plutarch, Epit;Pseudo-Plutarch, Epitome
Seneca, QNat., Quaestiones Naturales
Stobaeus, Ecl., jEklogaiv [‘Selections‘]
Theophr. ap. Simpl. Phys., Theophrastus, ap. Simplicius, in Physics

Author Information

Patricia O’Grady
Email: Patricia.OGrady@flinders.edu.au
The Flinders University of South Australia
Australia

Prosentential Theory of Truth

Prosentential theorists claim that sentences such as “That is true” are prosentences that function analogously to their better known cousins—pronouns. For example, just as we might use the pronoun ‘he’ in place of ‘James’ to transform “James went to the supermarket” into “He went to the supermarket,” so we might use the prosentence-forming operator ‘is true’ to transform “Snow is white” into “‘Snow is white’ is true.” According to the prosentential theory of truth, whenever a referring expression (for example, a definite description or a quote-name) is joined to the truth predicate, the resulting statement contains no more content than the sentence(s) picked out by the referring expression. To assert that a sentence is true is simply to assert or reassert that sentence; it is not to ascribe the property of truth to that sentence. The prosentential theory is one kind of deflationary theory of truth. Like all deflationary theories, it provides an alternative to explanations of truth that analyze truth in terms of reference, predicate satisfaction or a correspondence relation.

What is a Prosentence?
Quantificational Prosentences
Why the Prosentential Theory is Deflationary
The Recognition-Transcendence of Truth
A Prosentential Theory of Falsity
The Liar Paradox
Objections
Prosentential Theory vs. Other Deflationary Theories
References and Further Reading

1. What is a Prosentence?

The prosentential theory was first developed by Dorothy Grover, Joseph Camp, Jr., and Nuel Belnap, Jr. (1975) and Grover (1992) and has received renewed attention due to the work of Robert Brandom (1994). The central claim of the prosentential theory is that ‘x is true’ functions as a prosentence-forming operator rather than a property-ascribing locution. Perhaps the best way to begin an explication of the prosentential theory is by looking at the more familiar proforms found in ordinary English usage. ‘Proform’ is the generic name for the linguistic category of expressions that ‘stand in’ for other expressions—pronouns being the most familiar variety.

Most uses of pronouns are lazy—the antecedents of the pronouns could have easily been used instead of the pronouns. For example,

(1) Mary wanted to buy a car, but she could only afford a motorbike.

(2) If she can afford it, Jane will go.

(3) John visited us. It was a surprise.

(4) Mary said that the moon is made of green cheese, but I didn’t believe it.

‘She’ simply stands in for ‘Mary’ in (1), and ‘she’ stands in for ‘Jane’ in (2), even though ‘she’ appears before ‘Jane.’ In (3) ‘it’ refers to the event of John’s having visited us, while in (4) ‘it’ refers to Mary’s statement. Lazy uses of pronouns are convenient but perhaps not essential linguistic conventions.

In addition to lazy uses of pronouns, there are also ‘quantificational uses,’ as in:

(5) If any car overheats, don’t buy it.

(6) Each positive integer is such that if it is even, adding 1 to it yields an odd number.

In these cases, the pronouns do not pick up their referents from their antecedents in the same straightforward way as pronouns of laziness do. Replacing the ‘it’ in (5) by the apparent antecedent ‘any car’ or the ‘it’ in (6) by ‘each positive integer’ yields the following.

(5′) If any car overheats, don’t buy any car.

(6′) Each positive integer is such that if each positive integer is even, adding 1 to each positive integer yields an odd number.

(5′) and (6′) obviously do not express the sense of the original sentences. ‘Any car’ and ‘each positive integer’ cannot be construed as referring expressions; rather, they pick out families of admissible expressions that can be substituted into the claims. (5) and (6) should be represented as

(5″) (x)[(x is a car & x overheats) → don’t buy x].

(6″) (x)[(x is a positive integer & x is even) → adding 1 to x yields an odd number].

More will be said about quantificational proforms below.

There are also many commonly used proforms that are not often recognized as proforms. These include proverbs:

(7) Dance as we do

(8) Mary ran quickly, so Bill did too

proadjectives:

(9) We must strive to make men happy and to keep them so

and proadverbs:

(10) She twitched violently, and while so twitching, expired.

Most importantly, defenders of the prosentential theory of truth claim that English also contains prosentences. For example,

(11) Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: That is true.

(12) John: Bill claims that there are people on Mars but I don’t believe that it is true.

In these examples, ‘that is true’ and ‘it is true’ serve as ‘prosentences of laziness.’ They inherit their content from antecedent statements, just as pronouns inherit their reference from antecedent singular terms. John’s use of ‘it is true’ is lazy because he could have easily repeated the content of Bill’s claim without using a prosentence. John could have said the following.

(12′) John: Bill claims that there are people on Mars but I don’t believe that there are people on Mars.

The relation between a proform and its antecedent is called a relation of ‘anaphora.’ Defenders of the prosentential theory claim that prosentences such as ‘it is true’ and ‘that is true’ do not have any content of their own. Whatever content they have is inherited from their anaphoric antecedents. Because prosentences simply stand in for other sentences, prosentential theorists claim that utterances of ‘p’ and ‘p is true’ always have the same content.

There are many more kinds of prosentences than ‘that is true’ or ‘it is true.’ Each of the following sentences, for example, is also a prosentence.

(13) Goldbach’s conjecture is true.

(14) ‘Snow is white’ is true.

(15) The claim that grass is green is true.

According to the prosentential theory, sentences (13), (14) and (15) say no more than sentences (16), (17) and (18), respectively.

(16) Every even number is the sum of two primes.

(17) Snow is white.

(18) Grass is green.

Each prosentence is formed by conjoining some expression that refers to a sentence to the truth predicate.

Although the semantic content of prosentences and their antecedents is the same, prosentences often differ in pragmatic respects from their antecedents. Consider the difference between the following cases:

(11) Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: That is true.

(11′) Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: There are people on Mars.

Although Mary’s utterance in (11′) asserts no more than her utterance in (11), her utterance in (11′) does not acknowledge that Bill has said anything. By acknowledging Bill’s previous statement, Mary’s utterance of ‘that is true’ avoids a kind of assertional plagiarism and has the effect of expressing agreement. Mary could have uttered her statement in (11′) without ever having heard Bill say anything and without, therefore, expressing any kind of agreement. Thus, the prosentential theory takes up the point emphasized by F. P. Ramsey’s redundancy theory of truth that assertions of truth do not assert anything new. Unlike redundancy theories, however, the prosentential theory does not take the truth predicate to be always eliminable without loss. What would be lost in (11′) is Mary’s acknowledgment that Bill had said something.

One of the prosentential theory’s most important claims about the truth predicate is that it is not used to ascribe a substantive property to propositions. Grover (1992, p. 221) writes,

Many other truth theories assume that a sentence containing a truth predication, e.g., ‘That is true,’ is about its antecedent sentence (‘Chicago is large’) or an antecedent proposition. By contrast, the prosentential account is that ‘That is true’ does not say anything about its antecedent sentence (e.g., ‘Chicago is large’) but says something about an extralinguistic subject (e.g., Chicago).

The truth predicate is not used to say something about sentences or propositions. It is used to say something about the world. As Grover (1992, p. 221) puts it, prosentences function “at the level of the object language.” Even when someone makes an utterance such as “John’s last claim is true”—which uses a referring expression that explicitly mentions an antecedent utterance token—the prosentential theory still denies that it is the utterance that is being talked about. The person uttering this sentence “expresses an opinion about whatever (extralinguistic thing) it was that John expressed an opinion about” (Grover, 1992, p. 19). W. V. Quine (1970, pp. 10-11) makes a similar claim, stating that the truth predicate serves “to point through the sentence to reality; it serves as a reminder that though sentences are mentioned, reality is still the whole point.” The prosentential theory uses the notion of the anaphoric inheritance of content to explain how reality remains the focus in such cases.

2. Quantificational Prosentences

In addition to lazy uses of prosentences, there are also ‘quantificational’ uses. For example,

(19) Everything John said is true

is a quantificational prosentence. A first attempt to translate (19) into a language containing bound propositional variables might read

(20) (p)(If John said that p, then p is true).

A natural language paraphrase of (20) which exhibits ‘it is true’ as a quantificationally dependent prosentence would be

(21) For anything one can say, if John said it, then it is true. (Grover, 1992, p. 130)

Since, according to the prosentential theory, the statement ‘p is true’ says no more than the statement ‘p,’ the truth predicate in (20) can be dropped to yield

(20′) (p)(If John said that p, then p).

If the variable ‘p’ ranges over objects and take names of objects as its substitution instances—i.e., if ‘(p)’ and ‘p’ are given their ordinary interpretations—then the consequent of the conditional inside (20′) will not be a grammatical expression. The antecedents and consequents of conditionals must be complete sentences. In order for (20′) to be a grammatical expression, two modifications in the standard interpretation of variables and quantifiers must be made. First, the variable ‘p’ must be understood to be a propositional variable, taking entire propositions instead of names of propositions as its substitution instances. Secondly, the universal quantifier ‘(p)’ must be understood substitutionally, since the traditional, objectual interpretation of the quantifiers does not square well with the use of propositional variables. A statement using the particular (or existential) substitutional quantifier is true just in case the open sentence following the quantifier has at least one true substitution instance; while a statement using the universal substitutional quantifier is true in case every substitution instance is true (cf. David, 1994, p. 85). In order to avoid confusion between the objectual and substitutional interpretations of the quantifiers, I shall use ‘∀p’ to designate the universal substitutional quantifier. (20′), then, should read

(20″) ∀p(If John said that p, then p).

If, however, we interpret the conditional in (20″) as a material conditional, (20″) will still misrepresent the content of (19).

To see why this is so, consider the fact that universally quantified statements can be understood as conjunctions of all their possible substitution instances. For example, (20″) is equivalent to

(22) (If John said that p₁, then p₁ is true) & (If John said that p₂, then p₂ is true) & (If John said that p₃, then p₃ is true) & … & (If John said that p_n, then p_n is true).

How many conjuncts make up the content of (22) will depend upon the size of the domain of discourse in question. That is, it will depend upon how many possible values of p there are. If the domain of the variable ‘p’ is the set of all things that can be said, then (22) will consist of an indefinitely large conjunction of substitution instances. Most of the conjuncts will be vacuously true by virtue of having false antecedents—i.e., there will be indefinitely many things that John did not say. This means that each of the indefinitely many conditionals formed from things that John did not say is just as much part of the content of (19) as each of the conditionals formed from things John did say. That seems counterintuitive and contrary to the meaning of (19). Suppose that John made only the following three statements on the occasion in question.

(23) Gas prices are too high.

(24) Taxes are too high.

(25) Professional baseball players’ salaries are too high.

It is plausible to think that (19) says something about (23), (24) and (25) but not about (26), (27) and (28)—statements John never made.

(26) Gas prices are too low.

(27) Taxes are too low.

(28) Professional baseball players’ salaries are too low.

Yet if the quantification in (20″) remains unrestricted, then its content consists of a conjunction of conditionals having (26), (27), (28) and countless other statements John did not say in their antecedents.

If quantificational prosentences such as ‘Everything John said is true’ are to refer to only finite classes of claims, their quantifiers must be restricted in some way. One way to trim down the domain of ‘p’ in (20″) is to limit the universe of discourse to the set of all statements made by John. Let ‘U_J’ represent some particular universe of discourse, and let ‘{p|Øp}’ mean ‘the set of all propositions such that ‘Øp’ is true.’ If we limit the universe of discourse to all and only the things that John said, then we have

(29) ∀p(If John said that p, then p). U_J = {p|John said p}

‘∀p(If John said that p, then p)’ will then consist of a finite conjunction of true conditionals, one for each thing said by John on the occasion in question. This arrangement, however, has the unusual feature that, for every grammatical subject of such a universally quantified sentence, there will be a different universe of discourse. For every x, there will be a unique universe of discourse for each statement of the form

(30) ∀p(If x said that p, then p). U_x = {p|x said p}

Other quantificational prosentences that would be instances of (30) include

(31) Everything the Pope says about theological doctrine is true.

(32) Everything Henry Kissinger says about foreign policy is true.

Following the current suggestion, (31) could be symbolized as either

(33) ∀p(If the Pope said that p, then p). U_P = {p|the Pope said p & p is a matter of theological doctrine}

(33′) ∀p(If the Pope said that p & p is a matter of theological doctrine, then p). U_P = {p|the Pope said p}

The symbolization for (32) would be analogous. It is not clear that we will be able to capture what is common to all of these cases if each quantificational prosentence is tied to a distinct universe of discourse. Perhaps there is another way to limit the domain of ‘p’ in (20″).

Nuel Belnap, Jr. (1973), one of the founders of the prosentential theory of truth, introduced the notion of ‘conditional assertion’ to solve the problem of restricted quantification—i.e., where one wants to quantify over only a limited domain. All prosentential theorists now rely upon Belnap’s model to explicate the logical structure of quantificational prosentences. Belnap introduced the notation ‘(A/B)’ to stand for conditional assertion. Conditional assertion occurs when someone does not assert the conditional ‘If A then B’ as much as conditionally assert B—that is, assert B on the condition that A. Belnap formulates the following principle to capture this idea:

(B1) If A is true, then what (A/B) asserts is what B asserts. If A is false, then (A/B) is nonassertive. (Belnap, 1973, p. 50)

Quantifying into conditional assertions yields a restricted form of quantification, regarding which Belnap offers the following principle.

(B2) Part 1. (x)(Cx/Bx) is assertive just in case ∃xCx is true. Part 2. (x)(Cx/Bx) is the conjunction of all the propositions (Bt) such that Ct is true. (ibid., p. 66)

Applying Belnap’s conditional assertion notation to (20″) yields

(34) ∀p(John said that p/p).

The content of (34), then, is a finite conjunction of claims. But notice that it is not a conjunction of conditionals of the form ‘If John said that p, then p,’ each with a true antecedent. Rather, it is a conjunction of claims p₁, p₂,…, p_n, each of which satisfies the condition that John said it. The focus of such a claim is on what John said and only derivatively on the fact that it was John who did the saying. If the only statements John made were (23), (24) and (25), then the content of an assertion of (34) is exhausted by the conjunction of (23), (24) and (25). As a result, Belnap’s principle of restricted quantification solves the problem of how to interpret ‘Everything John said is true.’ Applying Belnap’s principles to (31) and (32) yields

(35) ∀p(the Pope said that p & p is a matter of theological doctrine/p).

(36) ∀p(Kissinger said that p & p is a matter of foreign policy/p).

Following Belnap’s interpretation of conditional assertion and restricted quantification, prosentential theorists can explain how quantificational prosentences have as their content finite conjunctions of claims rather than infinite conjunctions of conditionals, most of which are trivially true. Prosentential theorists thereby show that quantificational prosentences contain no more content than the anaphoric antecedents of those prosentences. Although quantificational prosentences may contain no more explicit content than their anaphoric antecedents, they can also be used as implicit attributions of reliability, where such attributions do not clearly appear in their antecedents. Cf. Beebe (forthcoming).

3. Why the Prosentential Theory is Deflationary

The prosentential theory of truth counts as a deflationary theory because it denies that any analysis of truth of the form

(37) (x)(x is true iff x is F)

can be given, where ‘x is F’ expresses a property that is conceptually or explanatorily more fundamental than ‘x is true.’ An analysis of truth would be appropriate if the truth predicate were a property-ascribing locution and the property that is ascribed could be broken down into more fundamental properties. However, prosentential theorists deny that uses of the truth predicate ascribe any property to sentences or propositions.

A common anti-deflationist approach to truth analyzes truth in terms of reference and predicate satisfaction. Stephen Stich (1990, ch. 5), for example, takes the proper analysis of truth to be

(38) ‘a is F’ is true iff there exists an object x such that ‘a’ refers to x and ‘F’ is satisfied by x.

Instead of denying the truth of statements such as (38), deflationists merely deny that they constitute analyses of truth (cf., e.g., Horwich, 1998, p. 10). Deflationists claim that the most fundamental facts about truth are the instances of the various truth schemata used by deflationary theorists. Consider the equivalence schemata employed by Quine’s (1970) disquotationalism:

(D) ‘p’ is true iff p

and Paul Horwich’s (1998) minimalism:

(MT) The proposition that p is true iff p.

Nominalizations of descriptive items are substituted on the left-hand sides of each biconditional schema, while the right-hand sides contain either descriptive items themselves or appropriate translations of them. Each of these theorists claims that there is no more to truth than what is expressed by the substitution instances of these equivalence schemata. Truth is not analyzed as a relation and the instances of the equivalence schemata are taken to be the most fundamental facts about truth. The prosentential theory claims that each of the favored examples of these deflationary theorists is simply a special case of the more general phenomenon of anaphora. Regardless of the points of disagreement among deflationary theorists, they all agree that instances of the truth schemata represent facts about truth that are more fundamental vis-à-vis truth than any fact given in an analysis such as (38).

Some theories, such as the correspondence theory of truth, take truth to be a relation between propositions and the world. Where ‘C’ expresses the correspondence relation, ‘y’ ranges over segments of reality, and ‘x’ is used—for the sake of convenience—as a placeholder for both descriptive items and the contents of descriptive items, we can represent a common version of the correspondence theory as

(39) (x)[x is true iff (∃y)(Cxy)].

(39) should read ‘For any (descriptive item) x, x is true if and only if there is a (segment of reality) y such that x corresponds to y.’ If truth cannot be analyzed at all, then it obviously cannot be analyzed as a relation. If, however, truth can be analyzed, then perhaps it would be appropriate to analyze it as a relation between descriptive items and segments of the world. How should one go about deciding between the correspondence theory and the prosentential theory?

Prosentential theorists respond by inviting readers to consider the following facts. The correspondence theory claims that snow’s being white is necessary but not sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white.’ In addition to snow’s being white, the proposition that snow is white must stand in a relation of correspondence to the fact that snow is white. The prosentential theory, by contrast, claims that snow’s being white is both necessary and sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white.’ As Alston (1996, p. 209) puts it, “Nothing more is required for its being true that p than just the fact that p; and nothing less will suffice.” One of the hallmarks of deflationism is the claim that the truth of a descriptive item depends only upon the meaning or content expressed by that item and how things actually stand in the world. Prosentential theorists and other deflationists hope that their readers will see that further constraints on truth are unnecessary.

The prosentential theorist’s claim that no analysis of truth can be given should not be confused with the claim that no explanation of truth can be given. The prosentential theory explains the function of the truth predicate by showing how ‘x is true’ functions as a prosentence-forming operator. (Because the prosentential explanation of truth makes the story about truth depend upon a story about how we use words and concepts, the prosentential explanation of the function of “true” generally leads theorists to adopt a version of the ‘use theory of meaning.’)

Deflationary theorists also claim that truth never performs any real explanatory work. Suppose, for example, that Smith successfully performs the action of attending a concert on Friday and that his action was in part based upon his belief that the concert is on Friday. If Smith succeeds in arriving at the concert on Friday, what best explains the success of his action? The non-deflationist answers that it is the truth of Smith’s belief that explains his success. His action succeeds because his belief is true. In other words, there is an important property of his belief (or perhaps a property of the proposition expressed by his belief)—namely, truth—that is central to any adequate explanation of Smith’s successful action. Deflationists disagree. They reply that the reason that Smith succeeded in performing an action based upon the belief that the concert is on Friday is that the concert is on Friday. There is no need to implicate a special truth property in this explanation. Why do actions based upon the belief that oxygen is necessary for combustion generally succeed (other things being equal)? Because oxygen is necessary for combustion. And so on. Because prosentences never have any content of their own, whatever explanatory burden one may wish for them to shoulder will always fall to their anaphoric antecedents.

4. The Recognition-Transcendence of Truth

Unlike some alternatives to the correspondence theory (e.g., the epistemic theories of truth of C. S. Peirce, Hilary Putnam, and Michael Dummett), the prosentential theory accepts that truth can be recognition-transcendent. Epistemic theories of truth always have epistemic operators (e.g., ‘justifiably believes that…,’ ‘warrantedly asserts that…’) of some sort on the right-hand side of their analyses of truth. For example,

(CSP) p is true iff the unlimited communication community in the long run would believe that p.

(HP) p is true iff one would be warranted in asserting that p in ideal epistemic circumstances.

(IJC) p is true iff it would be justifiable to believe that p in a situation in which all relevant evidence (reasons, considerations) is readily available. (due to Alston, 1996, p. 194)

Unlike correspondence and prosentential theories, epistemic theories always mention the knowledge, assertions or justified beliefs of particular people. Subjects and their beliefs do not figure into correspondence and prosentential theories in any way.

Truth theories such as (CSP), (HP) and (IJC) have the implication that there could not be any true propositions “such that nothing that tells for or against their truth is cognitively [in]accessible to human beings, even in principle” (Alston, 1996, p. 200). Summarizing a common thread of epistemic theories of truth, Alston (1996, pp. 189-190) writes,

The truth of a truth bearer consists not in its relation to some “transcendent” state of affairs, but in the epistemic virtues the former displays within our thought, experience, and discourse. Truth value is a matter of whether, or the extent to which, a belief is justified, warranted, rational, well grounded, or the like.

According to prosentential theorists, truth theories like (CSP), (HP) and (IJC) that focus on epistemic virtues are incompatible with the various truth schemata used by deflationists to explicate the concept of truth. Schemata such as

(40) p is true iff p

represent facts about truth that are so fundamental and obvious that the uninitiated often have difficulty seeing beyond their triviality to the significance of the deflationary thesis.

According to (IJC), snow’s being white is neither necessary nor sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white’ or the proposition that snow is white. If it is possible for all relevant evidence to be readily available and yet for this evidence to be unable to make a belief that snow is white justifiable, then ‘snow is white’ will not be true—even if snow is, in fact, white. Since this seems clearly possible, snow’s being white is not sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white.’ Moreover, if it is possible for all relevant evidence to be readily available and for this evidence to make the belief that snow is white justifiable even when snow is not white, then (since this seems clearly possible) snow’s being white is not necessary for the truth of ‘snow is white’ either. Similar considerations apply to (CSP) and (HP). Prosentential theorists claim that any theory which makes snow’s being white neither necessary nor sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white’ is inadequate. The equivalence schemata simply do not allow any room for the epistemic status of a proposition (or a belief or statement) being both necessary and sufficient for that proposition’s truth. In the eyes of prosentential theorists, epistemic theories of truth are incompatible with the equivalence schemata and their instances.

By contrast, the prosentential theory embraces the recognition-transcendence of truth. Truth schemata such as

(40) p is true iff p

do not require that anyone be able to tell whether p is the case in order for p to be true. In order for p to be true, nothing more is required than p. No one has to be able to verify or warrantedly assert it. The right-hand side of (40), then, does not limit truth to what falls within our thought, experience and discourse. As a result, the prosentential theory of truth is compatible with (though it neither entails nor is entailed by) a robustly realist metaphysics. It is a mistake to think that the correspondence theory is the only truth theory a metaphysical realist can buy into and that any critic of the correspondence theory will be an antirealist.

5. A Prosentential Theory of Falsity

The prosentential theory of truth can be extended to account for uses of the predicate ‘x is false.’ The prosentential theory of falsity will be strongly analogous to the prosentential theory of truth. The prosentential theorist can claim that, just as the predicate ‘x is true’ functions as a prosentence-forming operator, so does ‘x is false.’ When an expression referring to an antecedent utterance is substituted for ‘x’ in ‘x is true,’ the resulting claim will have the same content as its anaphoric antecedent. By parity, when a referring expression that denotes some antecedent utterance is substituted for ‘x’ in ‘x is false,’ the resulting claim will have the same content as the denial of its anaphoric antecedent. Consider the following example.

(41) Joe: The sky is cloudy. Jane: That’s true. Mark: That’s false.

Jane’s utterance has the same content as Joe’s, namely, that the sky is cloudy. Mark’s utterance, on the other hand, has the same content as the denial of Joe’s utterance, namely,

(42) The sky is not cloudy.

Mark’s utterance inherits part of its content from its anaphoric antecedent (that is, Joe’s utterance), but his utterance includes an extra bit of content not found in that antecedent: negation. Instances of the prosentence-forming operator ‘x is false,’ then, will have the same content as the negations of their antecedents.

6. The Liar Paradox

The prosentential theory of truth implies a solution to the liar paradox. Consider the following sentence.

(43) This sentence is false.

Is (43) true or false? If (43) says something true, then—since it says that (43) itself is false—it says something false. However, if (43) says something false, then—since it says that (43) is false—it says something true, namely, that (43) is false. We are thus confronted with a paradox.

Some attempts to solve the liar paradox involve extreme measures. Tarski, for example, thought that the paradox could be avoided only by eschewing ‘semantically closed languages’—i.e., languages which contain semantic terms that are applicable to sentences of that same language. He maintained that a theory of truth for a language should not be formulated within that same language. So, a theory of truth-in-L₁ must be formulated in some meta-language, L₂. If we allow the predicate ‘x is true-in-L₁’ to be part of L₁, paradoxes will result. The predicate ‘x is true-in-L₁,’ then, must be part of the meta-language, L₂. Since no well-formed sentence of L₁ can be used to talk about the truth value of any sentence in L₁, there is no chance for the liar paradox to arise because the basic liar sentence makes a claim about its own truth value. Tarski succeeds in avoiding the basic form of the liar paradox—but only at a very high price. He must content himself with providing an account of ‘true-in-L_i’ rather than an account of truth. And, since natural languages like English are semantically closed, Tarski’s theory also has the weakness of applying only to artificial languages.

Defenders of the prosentential theory claim that they can provide a solution to the liar paradox that is more natural and comes with a significantly lower price tag. According to the prosentential theory, (43) is neither true nor false because it fails to pick up an anaphoric antecedent. Just as I cannot inherit my own wealth, a prosentence cannot inherit its content from itself. Anaphoric inheritance is a non-reflexive relation that holds between two distinct things. A prosentence has content only when content has been passed to it from a content-bearing antecedent. Consequently, (43) will have content only if its anaphoric antecedent does. But if (43) is its own antecedent, (43) will have content only if (43) does. Since prosentences do not have their own independent content, (43) fails to have any content. Since it does not succeed in expressing a proposition, the liar sentence is neither true nor false and the paradox is avoided.

7. Objections

Philosophical objections to the prosentential theory of truth can be divided into two main groups. One set of objections is directed against Grover, Camp and Belnap’s (1975) original version of the theory; the other is directed against Brandom’s (1994) updated version. Originally, Grover, Camp and Belnap claimed that each prosentence—e.g., ‘it is true’ or ‘that is true’—referred as a whole to an antecedent sentence token. Each occurrence of ‘it’ or ‘that’ in a prosentence, they claimed, should not be interpreted as a referring expression. In fact, ‘it,’ ‘that’ and ‘…is true’ should not be treated as having independent meanings at all. Grover, Camp and Belnap were trying to undermine the idea that the truth predicate is a property-ascribing locution. They thought that if ‘it’ and ‘that’ were taken to be referring expressions, it would seem only too natural to conclude that ‘…is true’ ascribed a predicate to their referents.

One consequence of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s commitment to the non-composite nature of prosentences is that they are forced to find non-composite prosentences in places where there do not seem to be any. Consider, for example,

(13) Goldbach’s conjecture is true

and

(14) ‘Snow is white’ is true.

Grover, Camp and Belnap must argue that, despite appearances, (13) and (14) are not really composed of the referring expressions ‘Goldbach’s conjecture’ and ‘’Snow is white’’ conjoined to the predicate ‘…is true.’ According to the original version of the prosentential theory, the logical form of (13) is actually something like

(13′) For any sentence, if it is Goldbach’s conjecture, then it is true

(13″) There is a unique sentence, such that Goldbach conjectured that it is true, and it is true.

The logical form of (14) would be either

(14′) For any sentence, if it is ‘Snow is white,’ then it is true

(14″) Consider: snow is white. That is true. (Grover, Camp and Belnap, p. 103)

(Each of these interpretations has been suggested by some prosentential theorist.) In three of the four interpretations, quantifiers are introduced so that the prosentence ‘it is true’ can remain an unbroken unit. Universal quantifiers are used in (13() and (14(), and an existential quantifier is used in (13″).

An obvious objection to Grover, Camp and Belnap’s strategy is that it seems quite unlikely that (13′) and (14′) or (13″) and (14″) reveal the true logical structure of (13) and (14). There is no good reason to suppose that the surface structure of (13) and (14) hides genuine quantifiers below the surface. Furthermore, there are simply too many uses of the truth predicate outside of the phrases ‘it is true’ and ‘that is true’ for Grover, Camp and Belnap’s interpretation to be plausible. (Cf. Brandom (1994, pp. 303-305) and Kirkham (1992, pp. 325-329) for more critical discussion of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s early version of the prosentential theory.)

Brandom (1994, pp. 303-305) has argued that prosentential theorists do not need to treat ‘it is true’ and ‘that is true’ as non-composite units. Instead, he claims that ‘…is true’ should be treated as a prosentence-forming operator. When it is conjoined to any kind of referring expression, the resulting expression will have the same content as the antecedent sentence or utterance denoted by the referring expression. (This is the version of the prosentential theory that I have been assuming throughout.) However, a different set of problems confronts this version of the prosentential theory. Consider the following example inspired by Wilson’s (1990) criticisms of the prosentential theory.

(44) Steve: Boudreaux won the mayoral election. Kate: What that conniving, good-for-nothing bum said was true.

If Brandom’s version of the prosentential theory is correct, Kate’s utterance should have no more content than Steve’s. Clearly, however, Kate’s remark does more than simply reassert the content of Steve’s remark. It casts aspersions on Steve’s character. According to Brandom’s seemingly more defensible version of the prosentential theory, a referring expression used at the head of a prosentence serves only to pick out an antecedent from which the prosentence can inherit its content. But referring expressions can be naughty or nice, informative or dull. Once Brandom opens the door for prosentences to be formed by conjoining any referring expression to the prosentence-forming operator ‘…is true,’ it seems that he can no longer maintain that prosentences never have any more content than their anaphoric antecedents. Referring expressions are not all like proper names. Very often they bring with them a great deal more content than is strictly necessary for them to succeed in referring. A proper interpretation of prosentences cannot ignore this extra content. (Cf. Wilson (1990) for more criticisms that apply to both versions of the prosentential theory.)

8. Prosentential Theory vs. Other Deflationary Theories

According to F. P. Ramsey’s redundancy theory, one of the earliest deflationary theories, sentences such as

(45) The earth is round

and

(46) It is true that the earth is round

say exactly the same thing. The phrase “It is true” is a superfluous addition. Ramsey did not, however, explain why phrases like “It is true that…” or “…is true” exist at all if they serve no real purpose. The prosentential theory incorporates Ramsey’s claim about redundancy of content in its account of the function of prosentences. Since prosentences inherit their content from their anaphoric antecedents, they will say the same thing as their antecedents. However, the prosentential theory goes beyond the redundancy theory by providing an explanation of why we have the truth predicate in our language. Prosentences of laziness (e.g., “That’s true” spoken after someone utters “It’s very humid in Louisiana”), it is argued, give us a way of expressing agreement without having to repeat what has been said while at the same time acknowledging that an assertion has been made. Also, quantificational prosentences (e.g., “Everything Henry Kissinger says is true”) enable us to state generalizations when we might be unable to state each individual instance of any such generalization.

The prosentential theory also tries to incorporates some of the central claims of P. F. Strawson’s performative theory of truth. According to Strawson, statements such as “That’s true” (uttered after someone says that the sun is bright) or “It is true that the sun is bright” are nonassertoric performative utterances. An utterance is nonassertoric if it does not make an assertion. Commands (e.g., “Clean your room”) are examples of nonassertoric utterances because they do not purport to state or describe any facts. Similarly, according to Strawson, “It is true” (uttered after someone says that the sun is bright) and “It is true that the sun is bright” do not assert that some sentence or proposition has the property of being true. Rather, these are performative utterances, which do not so much say something as do something. In these cases the truth predicate is being used to express agreement or to endorse some claim.

The prosentential theory follows Strawson’s performative theory in denying that the truth predicate ascribes a truth property to propositions or statements. However, the prosentential theory does not deny that prosentences—while they may very well be used to express agreement—also assert something in the act of expressing this agreement. In addition, the prosentential theory can accommodate one type of case that causes trouble for the performative theory. Many embedded uses of the truth predicate do not seem to be expressions of agreement, as in “If what he said is true, we’ll be out of this building before winter.” Such a use of the truth predicate may very well not express agreement. The speaker may be unsure whether he should endorse the claim and may be merely thinking hypothetically. The prosentential theory does not require that every use of the truth predicate be an expression of agreement—although they can be used to do so. It explains that prosentences—even those that are embedded in the antecedents of conditionals (e.g., “what he said is true”)—inherit their content from their anaphoric antecedents.

W. V. Quine’s (1970) disquotational theory of truth views the truth predicate as a convenient device of ‘semantic ascent.’ When, for example,

we want to generalize on ‘Tom is mortal or Tom is not mortal,’ ‘Snow is white or snow is not white,’ and so on, we ascend to talk of truth and of sentences, saying ‘Every sentence of the form ‘p or not p’ is true,’ or ‘Every alternation of a sentence with its negation is true.’ What prompts this semantic ascent is not that ‘Tom is mortal or Tom is not mortal’ is somehow about sentences while ‘Tom is mortal’ and ‘Tom is Tom’ are about Tom. All three are about Tom. We ascend only because of the oblique way in which the instances over which we are generalizing are related to one another. (Quine, 1970, p. 11)

The truth predicate, then, exists because it enables us to form certain generalizations that would otherwise quite difficult to state without some such device of semantic ascent. When, however, the truth predicate is used with single sentences (e.g., “‘Snow is white’ is true”), it is superfluous.

Defenders of the prosentential theory agree with Quine (1970, p. 12) that, “despite a technical ascent to talk of sentences, our eye is on the world” when we use the truth predicate. In other words, both Quine’s disquotationalism and the prosentential theory deny that the truth predicate is used to ascribe a property to propositions. The truth predicate, they claim, is used to say something about the world. The prosentential theory also acknowledges the important role the truth predicate plays in forming generalizations that might otherwise be difficult or impossible to state (cf. the discussion of quantificational prosentences above). Furthermore, both theories explain truth by explaining the role of certain linguistic items (e.g., devices of semantic ascent, prosentences) rather than focusing on language-independent propositions and properties.

However, unlike disquotationalism, the prosentential theory recognizes that there are many uses of the truth predicate in which there is nothing to disquote. For example, in the sentence “Goldbach’s conjecture is true,” there are no quotation marks to be removed. Instead of being used in connection with an entire sentence, here the truth predicate is joined to an expression (‘Goldbach’s conjecture’) referring to an antecedent sentence. It is not clear how the disquotational theory might be extended to cover this kind of case. The prosentential theory explains that any referring expression (e.g., a name, definite description, etc.) inherits its content from its anaphoric antecedent(s) and, when such an expression is conjoined to the truth predicate, a prosentence with the same content as the antecedent(s) results.

Paul Horwich’s minimalist theory of truth (1998)—unlike the prosentential theory and some other deflationary theories—takes the primary bearers of truth to be propositions rather than sentences or utterances. Horwich claims that the conjunction of all the instances of the schema

(MT) The proposition that p is true iff p

yields an implicit definition of truth. Each instance is an axiom of his theory. How many instances are there? There’s one for every possible proposition, including propositions no human being understands and maybe even a few that no human being could ever understand. In other words, there are infinitely many. Horwich claims that there is nothing more to our concept of truth than our disposition to assent to each of the instances of (MT).

Horwich and defenders of the prosentential theory agree in thinking that no analysis of truth can be given. Horwich, however, thinks that the truth predicate does expresses a property, since he believes that all predicates express properties in some minimal sense. Although the prosentential theory is typically described as denying that “true” expresses a property of any sort (see, for example, Lynch, 2001, p. 4), the writings of Dorothy Grover (1992)—the primary defender of the prosentential theory—are far from clear on the issue of predicates and properties. Grover claims that the truth predicate is not used to ascribe a property to propositions, but this is compatible with the truth predicate expressing a property in a minimal sense (à la Horwich) nonetheless. The fact that a certain Rolex is not used as a paperweight does not mean that it lacks the property of being able to weigh down papers. Grover also claims that truth is not a substantive or naturalistic property, but this claim is compatible with truth being an insubstantial or nonnaturalistic property (also à la Horwich). Since Grover does not sufficiently explain her remarks about substantive or naturalistic properties, it is difficult to tell how close her prosentential theory actually is to Horwich on this issue. Brandom’s (1994, ch. 5) discussion of the prosentential theory does not even broach the issue.

What is clear is that Horwich and defenders of the prosentential theory disagree about the virtues of the substitution interpretation of the quantifiers. Horwich recognizes that if he used substitutional quantifiers, his theory would be finitely statable. He explains, however, that substitutional quantifiers would be too costly an addition to our language: “The advantage of the truth predicate is that it allows us to say what we want without having to employ any new linguistic apparatus of this sort” (Horwich, 1998, p. 4, n. 1). Horwich also harbors doubts about whether we can spell out the notion of substitutional quantification without circularly relying upon the notion of truth (Horwich, 1998, pp. 25-26). In making this last remark, Horwich is thinking of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s unusual thesis that every use of a prosentence—even “‘Snow is white’ is true”—implicitly contains a quantifier. (Cf. section VII for more discussion of this point.) Since substitutional quantifiers must be brought in to explain every use of a prosentence, Grover, Camp and Belnap cannot explain substitutional quantification in terms of truth. However, Brandom’s (1994) version of the prosentential theory does not use substitutional quantification to explain the function of the truth predicate. He argues that, although quantificational prosentences employ substitutional quantification, lazy uses of prosentences—which are more fundamental than their quantificational cousins—do not (cf. section II above). Brandom, thus, avoids the problem of circularity.

9. References and Further Reading

Alston, W. P. (1996). A Realist Conception of Truth. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Beebe, J. R. (2003). Attributive uses of prosentences. Ratio, 02/2003; 16(1), 1 – 15.
Belnap, Jr., N. D. (1973). Restricted quantification and conditional assertion. In H. Leblanc (Ed.), Truth, syntax and modality (pp. 48-75). Amsterdam: North Holland Publishing Co.
Brandom, R. B. (1994). Making it explicit: Reasoning, representing, and discursive commitment. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
David, M. (1994). Correspondence and disquotation. New York: Oxford University Press.
Grover, D. (1992). A prosentential theory of truth. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Grover, D., Camp, Jr., J., & Belnap, Jr., N. D. (1975). A prosentential theory of truth. Philosophical Studies, 27, 73-124.
Horwich, P. (1998). Truth (2nd ed.). New York: Oxford University Press.
Kirkham, R. L. (1992). Theories of truth: A critical introduction. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Lynch, M. P. (2001). Introduction: The mystery of truth. In M. P. Lynch (Ed.), The nature of truth: Classic and contemporary perspectives (pp. 1-6). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Quine, W. V. (1970). Philosophy of logic. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Stich, S. P. (1990). The fragmentation of reason: Preface to a pragmatic theory of cognitive evaluation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Wilson, W. K. (1990). Some reflections on the prosentential theory of truth. In J. M. Dunn & A. Gupta (Eds.), Truth or consequences (pp. 19-32). Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.

Author Information

James R. Beebe
Email: beebe “at” yahoo “dot” com
University at Buffalo
U. S. A.

Sengzhao (Seng-Chao c. 378—413 C.E.)

Sengzhao (Seng-Chao) was a Buddhist monk who lived during China’s “Period of Disunity” between the stability of the Han and Tang dynasties. His Zhaolun (Treatises of [Seng]zhao) is perhaps the most significant text for the study of early Mādhyamika (“middle-ist”) or Sanlun (“Three-Treatise”) Buddhism in China. His work may be the only extensive compilation of early Chinese Mādhyamika treatises available, although no Mādhyamika “school” is likely to have existed in China until Jizang (549-623 C.E.) projected such a lineage back to the time of Sengzhao. Mādhyamika, a philosophical development that arose within Mahāyāna Buddhism in India during the first few centuries CE, concentrates on distinguishing between concepts and ideas as necessary but insubstantial tools for functioning within the world of conventional reality and the false sense of duality between subject and object that they often engender. As Sengzhao puts it in his Commentary to the Vimalakīrtinirdesha Sūtra: “Those things which are find their genesis in the mind; [those things] which originate in the mind arise from things. That region of affirmation and negation is a place of illusion.” Considered to have been a brilliant young monk who was the principal person responsible for the transmission of Mādhyamika teaching in China, Sengzhao has received a great deal of attention from scholars interested in resolving the question of the extent to which the Chinese fully understood the Indian religio-philosophical system and its relationship to the indigenous Daoist and Confucian traditions.

Life
1. Traditional Biography
2. Other Accounts
Works
Background
1. Indian Mdhyamika
2. Chinese Mdhyamika
The Treatises
References and Further Reading

1. Life

a. Traditional Biography

The Gaoseng Zhuan (Biographies of Eminent Monks), contains the following traditional account of Sengzhao’s life: The monk Sengzhao was a man from Jingzhao. His family being impoverished, Zhao hired himself out as a copyist in order to make a living. As such, he successively went through the Classics and History, in the process becoming proficient in writing. Zhao’s interests inclined towards the subtle and profound, having always considered Lao[zi] and Zhuang[zi] as particularly important in terms of the mind. After studying Laozi’s Daodejing, Zhao declared, “It is indeed beautiful, but I have not yet discovered the region where my spirit can settle down and my worldly ties be completely severed.” After a time, Zhao read the old [version] of the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra and was overcome with happiness and pleasure. Opening it repeatedly, he relished its flavor and exclaimed, “At last I know where I should be!” Because of this, Zhao became a learned monk, studying both the Vaipulya Stra and the Tripitaka.

Having reached the age for capping [coming of age], Zhao’s reputation had become widespread through the Passes and in the administrative capital. In time, however, quarrelsome people doubted the fame that had come to him primarily because of his youth. Coming from as far away as one thousand li, they entered the Passes and engaged Zhao in debate. However, since Zhao had a talent for profound thinking and was also an expert in pure conversation, he seized whatever openings he had and pointedly crushed his opponents, who could not obstruct him. In time, respected scholars from Jingzhao and from outside the Passes wondered at his discriminating arguments and considered trying to challenge him.

At the time when Kumrajva [a famous Central Asian Buddhist missionary to China, c. 344-413 CE] arrived in Gecang, Zhao followed him in order to become a disciple. Kumrajva highly praised him without limit. When Kumrajva moved to Chang’an, Zhao also followed him there. Yao Xing placed Zhao, Sengrui and other monks in the Xiaoyao pavilion, where they assisted in the examination and editing of the Buddhist treatises.

Zhao, being aware that the Sage [the Buddha] had passed on long ago, that the literature had come to take on numerous mixed interpretations, and that earlier translations of the texts had certain mistakes in them, regularly consulted with Kumrajva and greatly increased his comprehension. Therefore, following the translation of the Pancavimshatisahsrik prajnpramit Stra (Twenty-Five Thousand Stanza Perfection of Wisdom Stra), Zhao wrote the treatise entitled Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge in over two thousand words. Upon its completion, Zhao presented it to Kumrajva. After reading it, the master declared it to be beautiful and said to Zhao, “My explanations are on par with yours, but your wording and expression is far better!”

In time, the retired Lushan scholar Liu Yimin saw a copy of Zhao’s Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge. He also praised it, saying, “I did not think that among your monks there would be another Bingshu.” In turn, Liu Yimin presented it to his superior, Huiyuan, who also cherished it. Huiyuan exclaimed that he had never seen another like it. Accordingly, the entire community opened and savored the treatise, passing it from one to another repeatedly.

Liu Yimin also composed a letter to Zhao. Following this, Zhao wrote treatises on Non Absolute Emptiness, Things Do Not Shift and others. In addition, he commented on the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra and composed numerous prefaces, all of which remain extant. Following the death of Kumrajva, Zhao reflected on his teacher’s untimely death and eternal departure, feeling his longing desires and hopes vanquished. At this time, Zhao wrote the treatise Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization. This essay consists of ten explanations and nine arguments in approximately one thousand words. When the treatise was completed, Zhao presented it to his superior, Yao Xing….

Yao Xing’s response to Zhao’s work was very attentive to various details about the meaning and included praise for its completeness. He then ordered by decree that it be copied and distributed to all the members of his family. This action demonstrates how highly Zhao was regarded at this time. In the tenth year of the yixi period [c. 413-414 CE], Zhao died in Chang’an, having reached the autumn of his thirty first year. (Taishô shinsh daizokyô L; No. 2509; 365a-366b.1)

b. Other Accounts

A number of other accounts exist concerning the life of Sengzhao, though they rarely shed any new light on his work or activities. The Weishou [a collection of canonical texts] accords Sengzhao preeminence among the eight hundred or so scholars gathered at Chang’an: “Daorong and his fellows were of knowledge and learning all-pervasive, and Sengzhao was the greatest of them. When Kumrajva made a translation, Sengzhao would always take pen in hand and define the meanings of words. He annotated the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra and also published several treatises. They all have subtle meaning, and scholars venerate them.” (Hurvitz 54)

While adding nothing substantively new, this version highlights Sengzhao’s importance as a liaison between the Indian Kumrajva and the Chinese language. All indications point to the foreign master’s reliance on Sengzhao’s ability to “translate” the Indian terminology into stylistically acceptable Chinese. The gong’an (meditation puzzle) collection known as the Biyen lu (Blue Cliff Records) contains a tale concerning Sengzhao’s death which by all accounts is apocryphal. Despite its spurious legend regarding Zhao’s demise, within the gongan commentary supplied by the Chan (“meditation”; Japanese Zen) master Yunmen, we find another reference to his life that provides some insight into his correspondence with Liu Yimin. According to the Biyen lu, Sengzhao not only took Kumrajva as his teacher, but “he also called upon the bodhisattva Buddhabhadra at the Temple of the Tile Coffin, who had come from India to transmit the mind-seal of the twenty-seventh Patriarch. Sengzhao then entered deeply into the inner sanctum.” (Cleary and Cleary 1977:401)

2. Works

In terms of literary output, Sengzhao’s major extant work is the Zhaolun. This text is a product of the formative years of the Chinese Mdhyamika tradition, and consists of a preface, introduction, four treatises and a set of correspondence between Sengzhao and Liu Yimin, a lay monk from the nearby Lushan monastery. The Zhaolun represents one of the earliest and most comprehensive examples of the embryonic thought of the Chinese Mdhyamika school.

In fact, it may be the only extensive compilation of early Chinese Mdhyamika treatises available. Not only do we possess most of the works ascribed to Sengzhao, but the extant texts are full-length, internally logical discourses. By comparing the preface, internal evidence and Sengzhao’s biography, the following order of composition emerges:

c. 405: Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge
c. 409: Non-Absolute Emptiness
c. 410: Correspondence with Liu Yimin
c. 410-411: Things Do Not Shift
c. 412-413: Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization
c. 412-413: Introduction (if genuinely composed by Sengzhao, as tradition asserts)

In its completed form, as found in the Taishô shinsh daizokyô (Taishô XLV, No. 1858), the text is rearranged into the following order:

Things Do Not Shift
Non-Absolute Emptiness
Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge
Correspondence with Liu Yimin
Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization

In addition, Sengzhao is credited with a commentary on the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra, an obituary of Kumrajva, an afterword to the Saddharmapundrika Stra, and prefaces to four Mahyna texts: the Drghgama, the Shata Shstra, the Brahmajla Stra, and the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra.

The Chan tradition also attributes another treatise to the hand of Sengzhao, the Baozang lun (Treasure Store Treatise) (Taishô XLV, No. 1857: 143b-150a), though most scholars regard the work as spurious. Another work, entitled On the Identity of the Buddha’s Two Bodies, has been attributed to Sengzhao; this essay, however, is lost and no corroborating evidence of its existence can be found, either in Sengzhao’s other work or that of later commentators.

In his writing, Sengzhao routinely employs the standard tools of Mdhyamika discourse (see Ngrjuna). Thus, we find Sengzhao engaging in dialectical arguments in which he resorts to the tetralemma (four-cornered negation) as a “solution.” According to this formula, any proposition x entails four logical possibilities:

X is
X is not
X both is and is not
X neither is nor is not

Two of his treatises (Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge and Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization) follow the debate-like format of Ngrjuna’s Mulamadhyamakakrik (Verses on the Fundamentals of the Middle Way) [MMK]. In addition, Sengzhao became famous for his artful use of paradox, often reminiscent of the Daoist classic, Zhuangzi. This stylistic trait would make him a favorite of the later Chan school, which regarded Sengzhao as one of its unofficial patriarchs.

3. Background

a. Indian Mdhyamika

Mdhyamika, a philosophical development that arose within Mahyna Buddhism during the first few centuries CE, concentrates on breaking down the reliance on ordinary means of apprehending the world around us. While concepts and ideas are a necessary part of functioning within the world of conventional reality, our tendency to substantialize those concepts into metaphysical realities leads to behavior generating the basic problems of dis-ease (duhkha) and therefore becoming.

Indian Mdhyamika targets the mind’s natural disposition toward conceptualization, a tendency that both creates and fosters a false sense of duality ensuing between the perceiving subject and observed objects. By assigning distinctive names and characteristics to things, we unwittingly create a false dichotomy, particularly in terms of linguistic conventions. Ngrjuna (c. 150-250 CE) referred to this process as the proliferation of conceptual and verbal hair-splitting, or prapanca. He articulated the concept of “emptiness” (shnyat) – the view that neither subject nor object exist independently — as a soteriological device, a deconstructive tool to rid the mind of delusional prapanca. Defined in varying ways by Western scholars, prapanca refers to the mind’s natural tendency to both create elaborate networks of interrelated mental constructions and to cling to those constructs as real.

One who grasps the view that the Tathgata exists,
Having seized the Buddha,
Constructs conceptual fabrications [prapanca]
About one who has achieved nirvna.

Those who develop mental fabrications with regard to the Buddha,
Who has gone beyond all fabrications,
As a consequence of those cognitive fabrications,
Fail to see the Tathgata. (Garfield 1995:62)

These mental fabrications inevitably arise from the mind’s predilection for naming things. In trying to distinguish between things and their respective functions, we assign names as a means of identification. The process of naming itself involves the picking out of abstracted characteristics unique to an entity and declaring it to be the “essence” of the thing.

What human beings perceive as reality is nothing more than artificially manufactured distinctions between things which in turn re-combine into a sense of “I” and “it/them.” From the practical standpoint of everyday living and functioning within the confines of the mundane, these constructs are absolutely necessary. As conventional designations, however, their provisional descriptions have no bearing whatsoever on Ultimate Reality. When taken for the real, they become objects of clinging and therefore fuel for rebirth. Clinging to these fabrications both fuels the cycle of becoming and gives rise to quarrels and disputations.

Common people take their stand on their own points of view . . . and hence there arise all the contentions. Prapanca is the root of all contentions and prapanca arises from the mind. (Dazhi Dulun; Taishô XXV, No. 1509; 61a)

Dissensions abound as a result of the mind’s constant pursuit of what it mistakes for the real. Clinging to the ephemeral, the mind generates ignorance, following its own fantasies in contempt for the way things truly are.

As Ngrjuna goes to great pains to point out, his opponents and the common person continually misinterpret emptiness. One takes it to mean complete annihilationism while another understands it in a newly reified manner. In addressing his opponents’ contention that his emptiness leads to the utter destruction of the Buddhist doctrines of co-dependent origination, karma, the four noble truths and all conventional activity, Ngrjuna retorts:

You understand neither emptiness nor the reasons behind emptiness nor the meaning of emptiness. Therefore you create these problems for yourself. (MMK 24.7)

In his later commentary, Candrakrti (c. 600s CE) elaborates on this verse by connecting the opponents’ position to a misapprehension of the entire Mdhyamika program. Mdhyamika does not advocate a nihilistic position as alleged, nor does it take on ontological status within Ngrjuna’s philosophy. Rather, the purport of emptiness lies in its capacity as a soteriological device intended to calm the excesses of prapanca.

Emptiness is taught in order to calm conceptual diffusion completely; therefore, its purpose is the calming of all conceptual diffusion [prapanca]. (Huntington 1989:205)

Having pacified conceptualization and destroyed the proliferation of mental constructs, a state of equanimity is reached. No longer drawing artificial distinctions between things, no longer reifying the conventional, the one who grasps the real meaning of emptiness ceases apprehending mistaken perceptions of the self, and thereby realizes the ultimate soteriological goal of release.

When views of “I”and “mine” are extinguished, whether with respect to the inner or outer, the appropriator ceases. This having ceased, arising comes to an end.Activity and dis-ease having come to an end, there is nirvna. Activity and dis-ease arise out of conceptualization. Conceptualization arises out of conceptual hair-splitting [prapanca]. Conceptual hair-splitting ceases through emptiness. (MMK XVIII. 4-5)

b. Chinese Mdhyamika

Although Mdhyamika is known in Chinese as the Sanlun Zong (Three Treatise School), most scholars acknowledge that no such “school” existed until Jizang (549-623), who projected such a lineage back to the time of Sengzhao and the disciples of Kumrajva. The Sanlun Zong derives its name from its identification of three major texts as the focal point of study: the Zhonglun (Verses on the Fundamentals of the Middle Way) and Shi’er Menlun (Twelve Topic Treatise) by Ngrjuna (c. 150-250), and the Bailun (Hundred Treatises) by Aryadeva. In addition to these primary texts, the Chinese Mdhyamika concentrated on a number of secondary texts, as evidenced by the commentaries and prefaces to other Mahayanist texts, including the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra, Bodhisattva dhyna and the Brahmajla Stra.

Chinese Mdhyamika emphasizes the ontological, epistemological and soteriological qualities of emptiness. From this perspective, the main problem facing the unenlightened revolves around their reliance on conceptualization or naming for their understanding and apprehension of the world. In discussing false views concerning the nature of nirvna, Sengzhao points out that “the way of nirvna cannot be understood by grasping at either existence or nonexistence…. These seemingly objective mental projections of existence and nonexistence are merely regions of vain hope.”

Sengzhao elaborates on this point using the concept of “the emptiness of emptiness” (shnyatshnyat) in his Commentary to the Vimalakrtinirdesha Stra:

Those things which are find their genesis in the mind; [those things] which originate in the mind arise from things. That region of affirmation and negation is a place of illusion. (Taishô XXXVIII, NO. 1775; 372c.17-26)

Thus, neither object nor subject exist independently. Mind depends upon the conventionally real and the conventionally real in turn depends upon the mind.

4. The Treatises

a. Overview

Each treatise begins with a basic statement of the problem as understood by Sengzhao. In every instance, the fallacious interpretation of either an object or doctrinal position is immediately linked to the discriminatory activity of prapanca. Understood both in the sense of verbal argumentation and conceptual hair-splitting, prapanca plays a critical role in Sengzhao’s philosophy of religion. While rarely addressing the issue of prapanca directly, he alludes to the question throughout the treatises. Bringing these activities to an end represents the heart of not only the individual treatises but also the text taken as a whole.

Sengzhao traces the genesis of mistaken apprehensions to the interplay and co-dependency of words, concepts and existent things. One without the others proves untenable. Built upon the matrix of observing the phenomenal world (whose mundane existence is never questioned by Sengzhao), ordinary perception functions by assigning a name to individual manifestations and then conceptualizing the conjunction of that name and phenomenon into a self-existent entity with distinctive own-marks. Once the concept has been created and an appropriate name assigned, knowledge of that object is generated. With the presumed knowledge of the thing in hand, the unenlightened believe that they have grasped reality and therefore attained soteriological release.

Sengzhao relentlessly undermines the conventional practice of naming and conceptualizing, believing that the process lead to the delusions and contentions plaguing his day. While never concerned with language as such, he at the same time recognizes the fact that the continuous inter-generational usage of words establishes a common perception that the things so named and discussed possess discrete own-being. Sengzhao certainly does not believe that from the standpoint of the ordinary person this is a well-thought-out “philosophical” system. On the contrary, he continually bemoans the fact that most people simply do not take the time to reflect upon their everyday assumptions.

By opposing the worldly [perception], our words appear insipid and flavorless, which then prevents the common person from deciding between either accepting or rejecting [the correct perspective]. The inferior person simply washes their hands of it and forgets about these matters. . . . It is indeed grievous to me that people’s affections have been led astray for so long, that the truth lies in front of them and yet they remain unaware of its existence. (Things Do Not Shift)

Truth is under our feet, in front of our eyes and yet we lack either the ability or will to apprehend reality. While displaying a sense of compassion for the ordinary person, Sengzhao at the same time roundly criticizes those who argue and dispute over the nature of reality. Those philosophers and religious practitioners who embark on the spiritual journey but get waylaid by mind games and conceptual elaboration are held accountable for their misapprehensions. Sengzhao immediately takes the contentious, the quarrelsome and the polemical to task in the introductory remarks of each treatise. This practice serves as one indication of his primary objective in dismantling the propagation of conceptual and verbal hair-splitting.

b. Things Do Not Shift

Accordingly, the first treatise begins with Sengzhao’s characterization of the commonplace perception of reality. Life, death, the seasons and all things seemingly rotate and change position in a continuous round of movement. In actual fact, however, no motion exists because the concept of motion presupposes a separation and distinction between things which does not ultimately obtain. Motion and its presumed opposite, rest, are nothing more than one and the same thing from the perspective of absolute truth (paramrthasatya).

Those who remain deceived, however, cannot comprehend their concurrence, giving rise to “quarrels and the drawing of distinctions. [Thus], the ancient pathways are overrun by lovers of difference.” The multiplication of conceptual distinctions and the resulting attachments to those differences generate a multitude of arguments among the unenlightened, hopelessly complicating the apprehension of the truth. If we neglect presenting the correct perspective, we merely “allow deceptive views about the nature of things to arise and then are unable to recover [the truth].” Sengzhao clearly has prapanca in mind when he criticized the lovers of difference, even though he never explicitly mentions it by name.

c. Non Absolute Emptiness

Similarly, Non-Absolute Emptiness begins with an eloquent description of the relationship between the enlightened sage’s wisdom and emptiness Apprehending the truth concerning the nature of emptiness, the sage engages the world while at the same time remaining unattached to its snares. Through his enlightened mind, he comprehends the absolute unity of all things in their suchness and deals with them accordingly. By way of contrast, the masses cannot possibly penetrate to the truth due to their reliance on ordinary understanding. As a result, numerous arguments arose concerning the nature of emptiness.

Conversations today all end up disagreeing when they arrive at the fundamentals of emptiness. Because they insist on disagreeing in order to come to some type of agreement, how will they ever settle anything? Hence, in their public quarrels they are unable to arrive at an understanding.

After describing three such misinterpretations of emptiness, Sengzhao underscores his contention that delusion arises through the compounding of things and names. Talk has done nothing but lead the masses to misapprehension and confusion, diverting them from the truth concerning the actual nature of things. Sengzhao therefore alludes to the co-dependent relationship between phenomenal things, naming, thought and reification.

A thing is a thing with reference to things, and so you might call it a thing; however, a thing which is a thing with reference to things is not [truly] a thing, even though we call it [a thing]. Hence, things are not identical with their names, which [do not] complete the thing’s actuality; names are not identical with the thing and are therefore incapable of leading one to the Ultimate.

The correct apprehension of the true nature of things lies completely outside of the morass of words and conceptualizations. Again, Sengzhao is not taking an anti-linguistic stance as such; he does not argue that language constitutes the root of all evil. However, he recognizes that we form our perceptions of the world based on the mind’s tendency to discriminate, distinguish and assign names to things presumed to possess own-being. His acknowledgement of language’s relative importance is reflected in the fact that despite its problems, he “cannot remain silent . . . [and f]or the time being . . . will utilize words . . . [in an attempt] to elucidate” the meaning of emptiness.

In the end, false conceptualizations are done away with and the arbitrariness of names established. Similes and metaphors function only to dislodge the mind from its discriminatory activity. For this reason, the sage engages the world of the phenomenal while remaining detached and identifies with the essential unity of the ultimate and mundane.

d. Prajn Is Without Dichotomizing Knowledge

Prajn (wisdom) is likewise undifferentiated from the One True Ultimate. With correct perception, the emptiness and subtlety of enlightened wisdom represents the culmination of all three vehicles. In ultimacy, neither distinction nor contradiction exists between the paths. Once again, however, “contentious arguments have recently led to confusion and differentiated theories” over the nature of prajn. The proliferation of prapanca has generated speculation that wisdom operates through discriminatory and dichotomizing knowledge. Therefore, Sengzhao feels compelled to dispel the falsehoods and illuminate the correct viewpoint.

After an introductory survey chronicling prajn’s arrival in China, the third treatise opens its substantive argument by depicting sagely wisdom as “subtle, its mysteries profound and [infinite depths] difficult to plumb. Markless and without conceptualization, it cannot be apprehended through either words or symbols.” In attempting to define it or use words to illustrate its nature, we inevitably dissect and create differentiations in regard to the sage’s mind and its functioning. Nevertheless, Sengzhao once again feels that he has no choice but to use words in discussing the matter.

e. Correspondence with Liu Yimin

Unfortunately, having committed description to the inadequacies of language, difficulties and new contentions arise when Sengzhao’s treatise arrives at Lushan. In his correspondence with Sengzhao, Liu Yimin, following his salutary remarks, acknowledges that while erudite, Sengzhao’s consignment of insight to the vagaries of language has produced disagreement and contention within the assembly.

To resign such a subtle principle to mere words is indeed dangerous; those who sing out in this manner find few who can comprehend. Those who cannot cut themselves off from clinging to manifested words and symbols will not grasp the meaning . . . [therefore] I wish to tell you of the doubts which your lofty treatise has raised in those seeking out differences in the mind of the sage.

Sengzhao responds by chastising Liu Yimin and his fellows for fixating on the mere form of words. Looking to the finger as though it were the moon, the scholar-monks at Lushan have equated the discriminative nature of concepts and words with the non-dual functioning of the sage’s mind:

Those participating in the discussions have become fixated on mere words. “In your investigation of the great space you search out the corners.” True understanding again lies outside the parameters of speech and conceptualization. You true gentlemen trained in the profound should know this teaching and understand.

One should abandon the search for the mere traces of truth and embrace the meaning behind the words. “Once one sets his mind to think about it, he begins to err; even more so if one attempts to use words.” Sengzhao advises the learned monks to desist from their reliance on the mundane perspective in favor of the non-dual apprehension of the enlightened.

f. Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization

Finally, in the case of Nirvna is Without Conceptualization, Sengzhao again defends orthodox teachings against those who would constrain the goal of final release to words and concepts. Misunderstanding the basic import of nirvna, the deluded believe it to be a substantive state, one to which they can attain while escaping the phenomenal world. Subtle and mysterious, the expansive, infinite void is unapproachable by the ordinary modes of sight and hearing, and therefore incomprehensible for the banal multitudes.

While the masses lack the capability to apprehend the nuances of nirvna, the philosophically minded have engaged in fruitless disputations which in the end have turned them against the very truth they sought. Inasmuch as they “care only for the words” describing the indescribable, they are “unable to comprehend superior thinking.” Hence, the purpose behind this treatise was to “silence the heretical discussions concerning that vast space.”

For those tied to words, the “one who does not name/conceptualize” [wu ming] proceeds to disabuse them of their views. As Sengzhao insists at the outset, while nirvna is unnameable and non-conceptual,

it is [nevertheless] spoken of as either having or lacking a remainder. These words surely only refer to the different signs of its emergence and remaining. They are simply false thought constructions applied to their corresponding manifestations.

Unattainable through either words or conceptualizations, nirvna consistently eludes reification. Seeking it by means of the worldly reduces the philosopher to stupidity, the rhetorician to silence and the materialists to despair. Accordingly,

the Buddha practiced silence while at Magadha; Vimalakrti refused to speak at Vaishli; Subhti taught the doctrine of no speech and Sakra, King of the Devas, heard nothing and yet it rained flowers.

Only when understood through the non-conceptualizing, non-grasping and non-discriminatory faculty of perfected wisdom does the soteriological take on its true character.

g. The Treatises as a Whole

Another important key to understanding Sengzhao’s thought lies in recognizing the pattern established between the Treatises and the logic inherent in their arrangement, a logic which ties the separate treatises together into a coherent demonstration of the path toward enlightenment. While never explicitly identified within the text itself, this design effectively discloses the logic of religious illumination and soteriological awakening. In following the development of the text itself, we can approximate Sengzhao’s vision concerning the path to enlightenment.

Through the emptying of emptiness, the text progressively moves the reader along a systematic presentation of the mutual relationships which ensue between the objects of cognition [Things Do Not Shift and Non-Absolute Emptiness], their subject [Prajn Is Without Dichotomous Knowing and The Correspondence with LiuYimin] and the ultimate result of correct perception into the nature of that relationship [Nirvna Is Without Conceptualization].

In following the text’s design, the reader is successively led through four interrelated steps:

The realization that things are devoid of an intrinsic self and therefore empty;
That the emptiness of things is not in itself an absolute to be grasped by the conceptualizing mind, in spite of the fact that it represents the ultimate perspective concerning the nature of all things;
Although without graspable, and therefore obtainable, characteristics, emptiness can nevertheless be realized through the medium of perfect wisdom, representing the subject of a knowledge that goes beyond conceptualization and the subject/object duality;
Inasmuch as wisdom illuminates emptiness, its knowing through non-knowing serves as the effective cause for the illumination of the non-conceptual, unnameable effect of the beginningless and endless nirvna.

As reflected within the text and already noted, Sengzhao and the early Chinese Buddhists recognize that conceptualization represents the principal obstacle facing the unenlightened. Fundamentally tied to the conception of an independently existing self, human beings consistently engage the world from the perspective of the ego, viewing the inner self as subject and all other things as objects. Granting existence to both self and others, we naturally create a disjuncture that results in clinging to some things while simultaneously rejecting others, unavoidably fueling the continued round of becoming. Breaking the cycle, for the Mdhyamika, begins with dislodging the mind’s attachment to logically absurd distinctions and its creation of erroneous oppositional categories such as existent/nonexistent, subject/object, nirvna/samsra.

In the final analysis, Mdhyamika sets out to demonstrate the logical absurdity of the cognitive process’ internal structure and the way it expresses itself verbally. In terms of the twelve links in the chain of becoming:

The root of cyclic existence is action.
Therefore the wise one does not act….
With the cessation of ignorance Action will not arise.
The cessation of ignorance occurs through Meditation and wisdom. (MMK XXVI.10-11)

To bring the proliferation of mental fabrications to an end is to put a stop to self-centered action and the refueling of samsra (the cycle of rebirth and suffering). Therefore, the mind represents the principal obstacle to full enlightenment while simultaneously possessing the greatest potential for attaining final release. Ngrjuna cites the Buddha in defense of his assertion that “the power of mind is greatest. By practicing the perfection of wisdom, [an aspirant] can shatter the great mound into tiny particles. . . . Insofar as the mind possesses none of the four qualities [form, scent, taste and density], its power is the greatest.” (Dazhi dulun 299c.5) Kumrajva likewise points to the mind as the root of human troubles and advocates a transcendence of all discursive thought.

[The Dazhi dulun] says that dissociation from all verbalism and quenching all workings of thought is termed the real-mark of all the dharmas. The real-mark of the dharmas is conventionally termed suchness, dharma-nature, and reality-limit. In this [suchness] even the not-existent-and-not-inexistent cannot be found, much less the existent and the inexistent. It is only because of fantasy-conceptions that each one has difficulties about existence and inexistence. If you will conform to the cessation-mark of the Buddha’s Dharma, then you will have no discursive fictions [prapanca]. If you figment fictions about existence and inexistence, then you depart from the Buddha’s Dharma. (Robinson 1978:184-185)

Sengzhao’s primary concern as a Mdhyamikan, therefore, revolves around the mind’s proclivity for naming and absolutizing. A natural operation of the “knowing” faculty, conceptualization functions through the cause and effect relationship of “knowing” arising as an effect generated by the “known” acting as cause. The known therefore function as the objects of knowledge’s knowing and so long as the objects are considered real or substantive, “knowing” represents the proper avenue for realizing the real. Activity and suffering arise as a result of conceptualization, which itself arises from mental fabrications located within the discriminative mind. Bringing to cessation the activity of the knowing mind represents the starting point for the self-realization of reality.

As Nishitani Keiji describes it, religion itself constitutes the “real self-awareness of reality,” by which he means that

our ability to perceive reality means that reality realizes (actualizes) itself in us; that this in turn is the only way that we can realize (appropriate through understanding) the fact that reality is so realizing itself in us; and that in so doing the self-realization of reality itself takes place. (Nishitani 1982:5)

In the end, Sengzhao and the Zhaolun take the reader full circle. Just as the mundane object of knowledge (things) is inherently empty, so too is the ultimate goal toward which things are striving. Unified in their emptiness, each is completely fulfilled and established in their home-ground. The sage has awakened to the wondrous mystery of self-realization, locating reality right where he stands. By following the design of the unified text, the reader can also attain to the attainable as Sengzhao gradually guides us through a thorough-going analysis of the factors of existence and core teachings of the Mdhyamika school.

Beginning with the establishment of the provisional nature of the myriad things and their inherent emptiness, Sengzhao systematically dismantles delusional conceptions concerning emptiness, wisdom and nirvna. In each case, the reliance on mental fabrications and reification of the inherently empty are shown to be logically inconsistent and therefore wrong-headed views about the nature of things as they truly are. Realizing through the power of wisdom and employment of skillful means that emptiness constitutes the true nature of all things, created as well as uncreated, the aspirant attains to the knowledge that ultimate reality is not an absolute lying outside the bounds of the phenomenal, but rather the absolute within the phenomenal. Immanent and yet inaccessible to the ordinary mind, only prajnpramit can bridge the chasm separating the common person from nirvna. Its use, however, within the context of and following the pattern established by the Zhaolun, will eventually end with the realization that

the one who follows after the Genuine becomes the same as the Genuine, while those who go after illusion become the same as illusion . . . [and] liberation exists in the midst of non-liberation.

5. References and Further Reading

Chang, Chung-yuan. “Nirvna is Nameless.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 1 (1974): 247-274.
Cheng, Hsueh-li. “Zen and San-lun Mdhyamika Thought: Exploring the Theoretical Foundation of Zen Teachings and Practices.” Religious Studies 15 (1979): 343-363.
Cheng, Hsueh-li. “Motion and Rest in the Middle Treatises.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 7 (1980): 229-244.
Cheng, Hsueh-li. “Truth and Logic in San-lun Mdhyamika Buddhism.” International Philosophical Quarterly 21 (1981): 261-276.
Cheng, Hsueh-li. Empty Logic: Mdhyamika Buddhism from Chinese Sources. New York: Philosophical Library, 1984; reprint ed., Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1991.
Cleary, Thomas, and J.C. Cleary, trans. The Blue Cliff Records. Boulder, CO: Shambala, 1978.
Garfield, Jay L., trans. The Fundamental Wisdom of the Middle Way: Ngrjuna’s Mulamadhyamakakrik. New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Huntington, C. W. The Emptiness of Emptiness: An Introduction to Early Indian Mdhyamika. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1989.
Hurvitz, Leon, trans. “Wei Shou, Treatise on Buddhism and Taoism.” In Yun-kang: The Buddhist Cave Temples of the Fifth Centruy A.D. in North China, Vol. 16 (supplement), 25-103. Kyoto: Kyoto University, Institute of Humanistic Studies, 1956.
Ichimura, Shohei. “A Study on the Mdhyamika Method of Refutation and its Influence on Buddhist Logic.” Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 4.1 (1981): 87-95.
Ichimura, Shohei. “A Determining Factor that Differentiated Indian and Chinese Mdhyamika Methods of Dialectic as Reductio-ad-absurdum and Paradoxical Argument Respectively.” Journal of Indian and Buddhist Studies 33 (March, 1985): 841-834.
Ichimura, Shohei. “On the Dialectical Meaning of Instantiation in terms of Maya-Drstanta in the Indian and Chinese Mdhyamikas.” Journal of Indian and Buddhist Studies 36.2 (March, 1988): 977-971.
Ichimura, Shohei. “On the Paradoxical Method of the Chinese Mdhyamika: Seng-chao and the Chao-lun Treatise.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 19 (1992): 51-71.
Liebenthal, Walter. The Chao Lun: The Treatises of Seng-Chao. 2nd rev. ed. Hong Kong: Hong Kong University Press, 1968.
Liu, Ming-wood. “Seng-chao and the Mdhyamika Way of Refutation.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 14 (1987): 97-110.
Liu, Ming-wood. Mdhyamaka Thought in China. Sinica Leidensia, Vol. XXX. Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1994.
Nishitani, Keiji. Religion and Nothingness. Trans. Jan Van Bragt. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1982.
Robinson, Richard H. “Mysticism and Logic in Seng-chao’s Thought.” Philosophy East and West 8.3-4 (1958-1959): 99-120.
Robinson, Richard H. Early Mdhyamika in India and China. New York: Samuel Weiser, 1965; reprint ed., Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1978.
Sharf, Robert. Coming to Terms with Chinese Buddhism: A Reading of the Treasure Store Treatise. Honolulu: University of Hawaii, 2001.
Tsukamoto Zenry. A History of Early Chinese Buddhism: From Its Introduction to the Death of Hui-yüan. 2 vols. Trans. Leon Hurvitz. Tokyo, New York, San Francisco: Kodansha International, 1985.

Author Information

Jeffrey Dippmann
Email: Jeffrey.Dippmann@cwu.edu
Central Washington University
U. S. A.

Nasir al-Din Tusi (1201—1274)

Nasir al-Din Tusi was the most celebrated scholar of the 13th century in Islamic lands. Thomas Aquinas and Roger Bacon were his contemporaries in the West.

The ensemble of Tusi’s writings amounts to approximately 165 titles on astronomy, ethics, history, jurisprudence, logic, mathematics, medicine, philosophy, theology, poetry and the popular sciences.

Tusi was born in Tus in 1201 and died in Baghdad in 1274. Very little is known about his childhood and early education, apart from what he writes in his autobiography, Contemplation and Action (Sayr wa suluk).

He was apparently born into a Twelver Shi‘i family and lost his father at a young age. Fulfilling the wish of his father, he took learning and scholarship very seriously and travelled far and wide to attend the lectures of renowned scholars and acquire the knowledge which guides people to the happiness of the next world. As a young boy, Tusi studied mathematics with Kamal al-Diin Hasib about whom we have no authentic knowledge. In Nishabur he met Farid al-Din ‘Attar, the legendary Sufi master who was later killed in the hand of Mongol invaders and attended the lectures of Qutb al-Din Misri and Farid al-Din Damad. In Mawsil he studied mathematics and astronomy with Kamal al-Din Yunus (d. 1242). Later on he corresponded with Qaysari, the son-in-law of Ibn al-‘Arabi, and it seems that mysticism, as propagated by Sufi masters of his time, was not appealing to his mind ,and once the occasion was suitable, he composed his own manual of philosophical Sufism in the form of a small booklet entitled The Attributes of the Illustrious (Awsaf al-ashraf).

His ability and talent in learning enabled Tusi to master a number disciplines in a relatively short period. At the time when educational priorities leaned towards the religious sciences, especially in his own family who were associated with the Twelver Shi‘i clergy, Tusi seems to have shown great interest in mathematics, astronomy and the intellectual sciences. At the age of twenty-two or a while later, Tusi joined the court of Nasir al-Din Muhtashim, the Ismaili governor of Quhistan, Northeast Iran, where he was accepted into the Ismaili community as a novice (mustajib). A sign of close personal relationship with Muhtashim’s family is to be seen in the dedication of a number of his scholarly works such as Akhlaq-i Nasiri and Akhlaq-i Muhtashimi to Nasir al-Din himself and Risala-yi Mu‘iniyya to his son Mu‘in al-Din.

Around 1236, he was in Alamut, the centre of Nizari Ismaili government. The scholarly achievements of Tusi in the compilation of Akhlaq-i Nasiri in 633/1235, seems, among other factors, to have paved the way for this move which was a great honou and opportunity for a scholar of his caliber, especially since Alamut was the seat of the Ismaili imam and housed the most important library in the Ismaili state.

In Alamut, apart from teaching, editing, dictating and compiling scholarly works, Tusi climbed the ranks of the Ismaili da‘wat ascending to the position of chief missionary (da‘i al-du‘at). Through constant visits with scholars and tireless correspondence, Tusi kept his contact with the academic world outside Ismaili circles and was addressed as ‘the scholar’ (al-muhaqiq) from a very early period in his life.

The Mongol invasion and the turmoil it caused in the eastern Islamic territories hardly left the life of any of its citizens untouched. The collapse of Ismaili political power and the massacre of the Ismaili population, who were considered to be a serious threat to the Mongols, left no choice for Tusi except the exhibition of some sort of affiliation to Twelver Shi‘ism, and he denounced his Ismaili allegiances.

Although under Mongol domination, Tusi’s allegiance to any particular community or persuasion could not have been of any particular importance, the process itself paved the ground for Tusi to write on various aspects of Shi‘ism, both from Ismaili and Twelver Shi‘i viewpoints, with scholarly vigour and enthusiasm. The most famous of his Ismaili compilations are Rawda-yi taslim, Sayr wa suluk, Tawalla wa tabarra, Akhlaq-i Muhtashimi and Matlub al-mu’minin. Tajrid al-i‘tiqad, al-Risala fi’l-imama and Fusul-i Nasiriyya are among his works dedicated to Twelver Shi‘ism.

In the Mongol court, Tusi witnessed the fall of the ‘Abbasid caliphate and after a while he secured the trust of Hulegu, the Mongol chief. He was given the full authority of administering the finances of religious foundations (awqaf). During this period of his life, Tusi’s main concern was combating Mongol savagery, saving the life of innocent scholars and the establishing one of the most important centers of learning in Maragha, Northwest Iran. The compilation of Musari‘at al-musari, the Awsaf al-ashraf and Talkis al-muhassal are the scholarly writings of Tusi in the final years of his life.

The ensemble of Tusi’s writings amounts to approximately 165 titles on a wide variety of subjects. Some of them are simply a page or even half a page, but the majority with few exceptions, are well prepared scholarly works on astronomy, ethics, history, jurisprudence, logic, mathematics, medicine, philosophy, theology, poetry and the popular sciences. Tusi’s fame in his own lifetime guaranteed the survival of almost all of his scholarly output. The adverse effect of his fame is also the attribution of a number of works which neither match his style nor have the quality of his writings.

Tusi’s major works are the following: (1) Astronomy: al-Tadhkira fi ‘ilm al-hay’a; Zij Ilkhani; Risala-yi Mu‘iniyya and its commentary. (2) Ethics: Gushayish-nama; Akhlaq-i Muhtashami; Akhlaq-i Nasiri, ‘Deliberation 22’ in Rawda-yi taslim and a Persian translation of Ibn Muqaffa‘’s al-Adab al-wajiz. (3) History: Fath-i Baghdad which appears as an appendix to Tarikh-i Jahan-gushay of Juwayni (London, 1912-27), vol. 3, pp. 280-92. (4) Jurisprudence: Jawahir al-fara’id. (5) Logic: Asas al-iqtibas. (6) Mathematics: Revision of Ptolemy’s Almagest; the epistles of Theodosius, Hypsicles, Autolucus, Aristarchus, Archimedes, Menelaus, Thabit b. Qurra and Banu Musa. (7) Medicine: Ta‘liqa bar qunun-i Ibn Sina and his correspondences with Qutb al-Din Shirazi and Katiban Qazwini. (8) Philosophy: refutation of al-Shahrastani in Musara‘at al-musari‘; his commentary on Ibn Sina’s al-Isharat wa’l-tanbihat which took him almost 20 years to complete; his autobiography Sayr wa suluk; Rawda-yi taslim and Tawalla wa tabarra. (9) Theology: Aghaz wa anjam; Risala fi al-imama and Talkhis al-muhassal and (10) Poetry: Mi‘yar al-ash‘ar.

References and Further Reading

Badakhchani, S. J. Contemplation and Action: The Spiritual Autobiography of a Muslim Scholar (London, I. B. Tauris in association with The Institute of Ismaili Studies, 1998).
Mudarris Radawi, Muhammad. Ahwal wa athar-i Abu Ja‘far Muhammad b. Muhammad b. Hasan al-Tusi. Tehran, Intisharat-i Danishgah-i Tehran, 1345s/1975.
Mudarrisi Zanjani, Muhammad. Sargudhasht wa ‘aqa‘id-i falsafi-yi Khwaja Nasir al-Din Tusi. Tehran, Intisharat-i Danishgah-i Tehran, 1363s/1984.
Madelung, Wilferd. ‘Nasir al-Din Tusi’s Ethics Between Philosophy, Shi‘ism and Sufism,’ in Ethics in Islam, ed. R. G. Hovannisian, Malibu, CA, 1985, pp. 85-101.

Author Information

S. J. Badakhchani
Email: info@iis.ac.uk
The Institute of Ismaili Studies
United Kingdom

Evidentialism

Evidentialism in epistemology is defined by the following thesis about epistemic justification:

(EVI) Person S is justified in believing proposition p at time t if and only if S’s evidence for p at t supports believing p.

As evidentialism is a thesis about epistemic justification, it is a thesis about what it takes for one to believe justifiably, or reasonably, in the sense thought to be necessary for knowledge. Particular versions of evidentialism can diverge in virtue of their providing different claims about what sorts of things count as evidence, what it is for one to have evidence, and what it is for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition. Thus, while (EVI) is often referred to as the theory of epistemic justification known as evidentialism, it is more accurately conceived as a kind of epistemic theory. In this light, (EVI) can be seen as the central, guiding thesis of evidentialism. All evidentialist theories conform to (EVI), but various divergent theories of evidentialism can be formulated.

Before turning to these issues, it is worth noting that evidentialism is also a prominent theory in the philosophy of religion. Evidentialism in the philosophy of religion has its own set of controversies, but this entry will not cover them. On evidentialism in the philosophy of religion, see Alvin Plantinga’s classic article, “Reason and Belief in God.” For a more extended discussion, see Plantinga’s Warranted Christian Belief.

A Brief Prima Facie Case
Developing the Theory
Objections
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. More Advanced Studies

1. A Brief Prima Facie Case

When we think about what it takes for one to believe reasonably or justifiably, we think that one has to have good reasons (or, more accurately, adequate reason for thinking the proposition in question is true). We think that one is not believing as one should when one believes something for no reason whatsoever or for very weak reasons. This dependence on reasons seems to be central to the very concept of justified belief. It should be no surprise, then, that the traditional view holds that one is justified only if one has adequate reasons for belief. Thus, evidentialism can be thought of as the default, or commonsense, conception of epistemic justification. Indeed, we can see the centrality of this conception of justification throughout the history of philosophy, especially in its grappling with the problem of skepticism. In order to justify denying skeptical claims, we want to know what reason we have for believing that skepticism is false. Traditional accounts have looked to one’s available evidence or reasons for an answer.

Naturally, then, we see this traditional conception reflected in the writings of many influential philosophers. David Hume, for example, writes that the “wise man. . . proportions his belief to the evidence,” and he proceeds with this as his epistemic ideal (73). Bertrand Russell endorses the view that “[p]erfect rationality consists . . . in attaching to every proposition a degree of belief corresponding to its degree of credibility,” credibility functionally depending on evidence (397-398). W.K. Clifford writes that “it is wrong always, everywhere, and for anyone to believe anything upon insufficient evidence” (518). Such quotations help to illustrate the dominance of the view that justified belief depends upon one’s having good reasons or evidence. Though this by no means settles the issue, it does provide reason to try to work out a theory of justification that appeals solely to evidence. The remainder of this entry turns toward a detailed consideration of the theory itself.

2. Developing the Theory

Richard Feldman and Earl Conee, two leading defenders of evidentialism, have explicitly defined evidentialism as a thesis about the justificatory status of all of the doxastic attitudes: belief, disbelief, and suspension of judgment. They write that doxastic attitude, d, toward p is justified for one at t if and only if one’s evidence at t supports one’s taking d towards p (15). So understood, evidentialism is not just a thesis about justified belief, it is also a thesis about justified disbelief and the justified withholding of belief. Only one doxastic attitude towards a proposition is justified for a person at a time, and this is a function of one’s evidence. Here, I focus on the core of evidentialism—the thesis about justified belief given in (EVI)—both for simplicity and because most treatments and criticisms of evidentialism focus on it. What is said about (EVI) can be extended naturally to the rest of the doxastic attitudes and thereby applied to Feldman and Conee’s explicit thesis.

a. The Justification of Propositions v. The Justification of Beliefs

Before proceeding, it is crucial to nail down more exactly what evidentialism is a theory of. As I have defined it in (EVI), evidentialism is the thesis that one is justified in believing a proposition at a time if and only if one’s evidence at that time supports believing that proposition. (EVI) does not entail that whenever one has adequate evidence for p one believes p justifiably. This is for two reasons. First, one can be justified in believing p even if one fails to believe it. For example, one might not believe p simply because one fails to consider whether or not p is true, yet one may nevertheless have good enough reason to think p is true and so be justified in believing p.

Second, one can have good enough reason to believe p and still believe it as a result of something other than this good reason. One might believe it as a result of wishful thinking, for example. In such a case, the evidentialist holds that the person is justified in believing the proposition in question but, nevertheless, believes it unjustifiably. One believes it for or because of the wrong reasons. One way of putting the difference here is by saying that evidentialism is a thesis regarding propositional justification, not a thesis about doxastic justification. That is, evidentialism is a thesis about when one is justified in believing a proposition, not a thesis about when one’s believing is justified. The latter requires not just that one have good reason to believe but also that one believe for those good reasons.

b. Evidence

As introduced above, evidentialism is a kind of theory of epistemic justification; one can formulate various divergent evidentialist theories by providing different analyses of its constituent concepts. The present section focuses on the central notion of evidence and explicates the various ways that one can restrict the sorts of things that count as evidence. Sections 2c. and 2d. turn to complexities in other parts of (EVI). Together, these three sections illustrate the diversity of possible evidentialist theories.

Evidence for or against p is, roughly, any information relevant to the truth or falsity of p. This is why we think that fingerprints and DNA left at the scene of the crime, eye-witness testimony, and someone’s whereabouts at the time the crime was committed all count as evidence for or against the hypothesis that the suspect committed the crime. The sort of evidence that interests the evidentialist, however, is not just anything whatsoever that is relevant to the truth of the proposition in question. The evidentialist denies that such facts about mind-independent reality are evidence in the sense relevant to determining justification. According to (EVI) only facts that one has are relevant to determining what one is justified in believing, and in order for one to have something in the relevant sense, one has to be aware of, to know about, or to, in some sense, “mentally possess” it. The sort of evidence the evidentialist is interested in, therefore, is restricted to mental entities (or, roughly, to mental “information”). In addition, it is only one’s own mental information that is relevant to determining whether one is justified in believing that p. For example, my belief that Jones was in Buffalo at the time the crime was committed is not relevant to determining whether you are justified in believing that Jones committed the crime.

Evidentialist theories can agree on this much while still providing differing accounts of evidence. For example, one might think that only one’s own beliefs can provide one with reason to believe something, as many coherentists do. An evidentialist might then hold that only belief states are evidential states. One’s experiences (that is, experiential states) then would not be evidentially or justificatorily relevant. The standard view of evidentialism, however, is that at least beliefs and perceptual states are evidential states. Not only what you believe but also what you experience can provide you with reason to believe that something is the case. Yet one does not have to stop there. One, for example, might also count memories, apparent memories, or seemings-to-be-true as kinds of evidence. In the end, what sorts of states one takes to be evidential will depend both on one’s intuitions about what sorts of things can provide one with genuine reason to believe and also on one’s strategy for responding to objections.

It is worth noting that while evidentialists have available many options about what to count as kinds of evidence, not just anything mental can properly be classified as evidence. In general, only those states or properties that are themselves informational (or at least can directly and on their own “communicate” information to the subject) can properly be classified as evidential states or properties. Regardless of whether one’s feeling of pain is an informational state, it does, so to speak, directly or on its own “communicate” information to one; so it is open to the evidentialist to classify it as an evidential state. By contrast, one’s ability to, e.g., identify complex geometrical shapes in one’s visual field is not itself a kind of evidence. (Even though this ability will undoubtedly provide one with evidence one would otherwise not possess.) The ability to identify complex geometrical shapes in one’s visual field is not a kind of evidence because it is neither an informational state, nor is it a state that directly and on its own “communicates” information to one. Instead, it is always something else that gets “communicated” to one via that ability. In general, therefore, cognitive abilities are not properly considered as part of one’s evidence. As we will see below, though, this is not to say that one’s cognitive abilities are completely irrelevant to justification on every evidentialist view.

c. Having Evidence

As alluded to above, not just any evidence whatsoever is relevant to determining whether one’s belief is justified; it is only the evidence that one has that is so relevant. The obvious restriction this imposes is that one’s evidence includes only one’s own mental states. One option, then, is to hold that one’s evidence at a time (or, alternatively, the evidence one has at a time) consists in all of the evidential mental states that obtain in the person at that time, including both occurrent and nonoccurrent mental states. On this view, one’s evidence includes not only one’s present experiences and those beliefs presently “before one’s mind” but also stored or standing beliefs, even if one is not presently able to recall or consciously consider them.

To see how this account of having evidence affects the consequences of the theory, consider the following example. Suppose that I believe that most television newscasters reliably report the day’s news. I find that television newscasters almost always report the day’s stories in ways consistent with that reported by other news outlets. For example, if the newscaster were to report that a fire occurred on Elm Street, I would also be able to find a report in the newspaper confirming that a fire did, indeed, occur on Elm Street. When I discuss this topic with people, they tend to agree that this is the case, and I have no strong evidence against this belief. It seems, then, that I justifiably believe that most television newscasters reliably report the news. Also suppose that fifteen years ago I heard reliable testimony that one newscaster, Mick Stuppagin, almost always provides incorrect reports. At the time, I believed that Mick was a very unreliable newscaster. Suppose, however, that although my belief that Mick’s reports are unreliable and the testimony that such is the case are still stored in my long-term memory, I am presently unable to recall them. If someone mentions Mick Stuppagin and asks whether I think he is a reliable newscaster, I may form the belief that he is a reliable newscaster on the basis of my justified belief that most newscasters are reliable.

On the view developed above, I would be believing unjustifiably, since I have outweighing evidence against p. I would not be justified in believing that Mick is a reliable newscaster even though I may be utterly unable to recall my evidence against this belief, even though my so believing may be completely blameless, and even though it may seem to me on deep reflection that I am believing as I should. Some may find this counterintuitive and, as a result, may want to formulate a more restricted account of having evidence.

One such option is to hold that the evidence one has at a time is restricted to one’s occurrent evidential states—i.e., those states involving one’s current assent, those presently “before one’s mind,” so to speak. On this account of having evidence, my stored memory belief that Mick Stuppagin is an unreliable newscaster is not evidence that I have at the present time. Furthermore, it is also not clearly true that I have as evidence my belief that most television newscasters reliably report the day’s news, and it is doubtful that my testimonial and inductive evidence for this belief is properly considered evidence that I presently have. The justificatory status of my present belief about Mick Stuppagin will depend solely on my occurrent evidential states. (The details of the case would need to be filled in order to determine whether or not the theory implies that belief is justified.)

The difficulty for this view is to show how such a restricted view of one’s having evidence can account for the justification of all of the beliefs we think are justified. For instance, we think we have some non-occurrent beliefs that are justified. We need an explanation of this. Similarly, it seems that as soon as I occurrently entertain the proposition that George Washington was the first president of the United States, I am justified in believing it, and its being so justified does not depend upon my consciously recalling anything. Those who restrict the evidence one has to one’s occurrent states need either to provide an explanation of this or to in some way explain away these common intuitions.

Other accounts of having evidence lie between these two extremes. A more typical “internalist” account might hold, for example, that the evidence one has at a time is that which is easily available to one upon reflection, so not all of one’s beliefs count as evidence that one has at a time. On this account, I am presently justified in believing that Mick is a reliable newscaster if and only if my stored memory belief that Mick is an unreliable newscaster (and its supporting evidence) is not easily available to me upon reflection. Various other accounts of having evidence can be developed that allow for varying degrees of availability or varying amounts of reflection. Guiding each account of having evidence are intuitions regarding cases similar to that above and intuitions regarding the extent to which justification is deontological.

We can conclude from the above that evidentialist theories can be formulated so as to account for widely divergent intuitions regarding cases. Furthermore, without a specific account of what it is for one to have evidence, it is not clear which proposed cases are to count as counterexamples to the theory.

d. Support

Recall that on the evidentialist view, S is justified in believing p at t if and only if S’s evidence for p at t supports believing p. We have already seen how evidentialists can provide different accounts of evidence and having evidence. The present section focuses on complexities with the notion of support.

Perhaps the most obvious issue that needs to be addressed in order to understand what it is for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition is the degree to which one’s evidence must support that proposition in order for one to be justified in believing it. Again, this will vary from account to account. One standard account understands it as follows: one is justified in believing a proposition only if the evidence that one has makes it more likely to be true than not. The likelihood of truth given one’s evidence has to be greater than 0.5 in order for one to be justified in believing the proposition, but the threshold required for knowledge might be much higher. In order to know that p, one might not merely have to justifiably believe that p; one might have to justifiably believe it to a certain degree.

This way of understanding the degree of support required in order for one to be justified in believing p is absolute, or we might say non-contextual. The degree required is the same across all possible cases. By contrast, Stewart Cohen presents a contextualist version of evidentialism. On his account, the degree to which one’s evidence must support a proposition in order for one to be justified in believing it will fluctuate with the conversationally determined standards that govern attributions of justification and knowledge. An immediate result is that one’s evidence for p may be enough to make believing p justified in one context (where the conversationally-determined standards for justification are relatively low) while failing to make believing p justified in another context (where the standards for justification are much higher). Evidentialism is, therefore, consistent with both contextualist theories of justification and non-contextualist theories of justification.

A further, more central epistemological issue regarding support has to do with the structure of justification. Evidentialism may be combined with foundationalism, coherentism, a “mixed” view such as Susan Haack’s foundherentism, or any other theory of the structure of justification. Each theory may be incorporated into evidentialism by understanding them as providing an account of the proper nature of epistemic support. Since foundationalism is far more dominant than the other theories, in what follows I will present one way of developing evidentialism with regard to it.

According to foundationalism, a belief is justified if and only if: either it is a foundational belief or it is supported by beliefs which either are themselves foundational beliefs or are ultimately supported by foundational beliefs. From the previous section, we have seen that it is only the evidence one has that is relevant to determining whether a belief is justified. Of all of this, foundationalism implies that only that evidence which is non-doxastic, foundational, or ultimately supported by a foundational belief is capable of supporting (or conferring positive justificatory status on) a belief. (Non-doxastic evidential states may include appearance states, direct apprehensions, rational intuitions, and seemings-to-be-true. For the foundationalist, some such evidential states are crucial as only they can justify the foundational beliefs.)

Assuming this framework, we can proceed as follows. In order to determine whether one is justified in believing that p, first isolate the portion of the evidence that is non-doxastic, foundational, or ultimately supported by a foundational belief. Only this is capable of justifying a proposition. Next, if the proposition under consideration is believed, subtract that belief and anything else whose support essentially depends on (or traces back to) that belief. (This last modification is intended to accommodate the foundationalist thesis that only the more basic can justify the less basic. See, for example, the discussion in section 3e. below.) Finally, determine whether this portion of one’s evidence makes the proposition more likely true than not. If so, then it is prima facie supported by one’s evidence (and thus prima facie justified). If not, it is unjustified, for it is not supported by the evidence one has that is able to justify one’s believing the proposition.

Note that I have had to add a prima facie qualification here. This is due to the, at least, apparent possibility of one’s support for a belief being defeated by other evidence one has that is neither non-doxastic, nor foundational, nor ultimately supported by foundational beliefs. An unjustified belief may be able to defeat the positive justification one has for believing p, but such unjustified beliefs have so far been excluded from consideration. In such a case, we may want to say that one would not be justified in believing p.

3. Objections

The aim in this section is to provide a sampling of objections that have been raised against evidentialist theories of justification. The aim is not to respond to these objections on behalf of the evidentialist nor to evaluate their strength. While the following are not objections to all possible versions of evidentialism, together they illustrate the difficulty in formulating a complete and adequate evidentialist theory. The chief difficulty for the evidentialist is to develop the theory in a way that avoids all such objections and does so in an independently motivated and principled way.

a. Forgotten Evidence

One kind of objection stems from the widespread occurrence of one’s forgetting the evidence that one once had for some proposition. We can distinguish between two sorts of cases here. According to the first sort, though one once had good evidence for believing, one has since forgotten it. Nevertheless, one may continue to believe justifiably, even without coming to possess any additional evidence. Evidentialism appears unable to account for this. According to the second sort of case, when one originally came to believe p, one had no evidence to support believing p. Perhaps one originally came to believe p for very bad reasons. Consequently, just after one formed the belief, one was not believing justifiably as one’s total evidence did not support believing that p. Suppose, though, that one has since forgotten why it is that one originally formed the belief and also has forgotten all of the evidence one had against it. Since it doesn’t seem as though in the interim one has to have gained some additional evidence for p, one might think that the subject of the second case remains unjustified in believing p. The relevant beliefs in both cases appear to be on an evidential par: neither belief seems to be supported by adequate evidence. The objection is that there, nevertheless, is a justificatory difference between the two cases, and evidentialism is unable to account for this.

The details of the cases proposed along these lines are crucial, for evidentialists may be able to motivate a denial of the critic’s justificatory assessment of one of the cases. This, however, is only of help when combined with an explanation for the justification of memory beliefs in general and memory beliefs involving forgotten evidence in particular.

Here evidentialists can appeal to the notion of evidence and to what sorts of states or properties are properly classified as evidential. For example, one may argue that the “felt impulse” to believe the proposition recalled from memory or its “seeming to be true” is itself a kind of evidence. On this account, in the first case one is justified in believing p because one does have evidence that supports believing p. The supporting evidence is the proposition’s “seeming to be true” or the “felt impulse” that accompanies the belief, but this very same evidence is present in the second case as well. Furthermore, this “felt impulse” or “seeming to be true” will necessarily accompany any memory belief, so there will be no cases along the lines of the second sort in which one has no evidence to support believing p. As a result, the critic’s appraisal of the second case is mistaken. In the absence of overriding counter-evidence, one’s memory belief is justified, so the correct appraisal of the second case holds that one is justified in believing p. In short, the critic’s justificatory assessment of the second case is mistaken.

b. Against a Probabilistic-Deductive Understanding of Support

A second objection targets the notion of one’s evidence supporting a proposition. As I have developed the notion of support above, part of it is given by some theory of probability. A body of evidence, e, supports believing some proposition p only if e makes p probable. If we suppose for simplicity that all of the beliefs that constitute e are themselves justified, we can say that e supports believing p if and only if e makes p probable. However, one might argue that, even with this assumption, one’s evidence e can make p probable without one being justified in believing that p. If this is so, the resulting evidentialist thesis is false.

Alvin Goldman, for example, has argued that the possession of reasons that make p probable, all things considered, is not sufficient for p to be justified (Epistemology and Cognition, 89-93). The crux of the case he considers is as follows. Suppose that while investigating a crime a detective has come to know a set of facts. These facts do establish that it is overwhelmingly likely that Jones has committed the crime, but it is only an extremely complex statistical argument that shows this. Perhaps the detective is utterly unable to understand how the evidence he has gathered supports this proposition. In such a case, it seems wrong to say that the detective is justified in believing the proposition, since he does not even have available to him a way of reasoning from the evidence to the conclusion that Jones did it. He has no idea how the evidence makes the proposition that Jones did it likely. Thus, the evidentialist thesis, so understood, is false.

The appeal to probability and statistics here is not essential to this sort of objection, so it would be a mistake to focus solely on this feature of the case in attempting to respond. Richard Feldman has presented an example which is supposed to demonstrate exactly this point. His example of the beginning logic student is supposed to show that being necessitated by one’s evidence is not sufficient for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition (“Authoritarian Epistemology,” 150). Feldman asks us to consider a logic student who is just learning to identify valid arguments. She has learned a set of rules by which one can distinguish between valid arguments and invalid arguments, but she has not yet become proficient at applying them to particular argument forms. She looks at an exercise in her text that asks her to determine whether some argument forms are valid. She looks at one problem and comes to believe that it is, indeed, a valid argument. As the argument is valid, she believes exactly as her evidence entails she should believe, but she is presently unable to see how it is that the rules show the argument is, indeed, valid. Despite her evidence necessitating the proposition that the argument is valid, it seems she is not justified in believing it.

Various responses are available to the evidentialist. One may here appeal to the distinction between propositional justification and doxastic justification in an effort to motivate the claim that the detective is justified in believing that Jones did it and the student is justified in believing that the argument is valid. When combined with a fully developed and well-motivated theory of evidential support, this may provide a response to these examples. Note, however, that this reply depends crucially on being able to hold that the logic student is justified in believing p but not justifiably believing p. This is a tenuous position, at least for standard accounts of the basing relation—i.e., for standard accounts of that which, when added to an instance of propositional justification, yields an instance of doxastic justification. The dominant view is that the basing relation is causal, and the student’s evidence for believing that the argument is valid is causing her belief, and it is not doing so in some non-standard, deviant way. The reply to the objection that appeals to the distinction between propositional and doxastic justification demands, therefore, that one also provide a satisfactory account of the basing relation, and none have so far been formulated.

An alternative response to these examples is simply to accept their lesson. One might just accept that such examples show that we need to develop a notion of evidential support that does not appeal solely to logical relations between one’s evidence and those propositions under consideration. For example, one might hold that one must, in some sense, grasp or appreciate the logical or probabilistic connection between one’s evidence and the proposition in question in order for that evidence to support it. Evidentialism allows for such possibilities.

c. Essential Appeals to Deontology

The view that justification is, in some substantive way, a deontological concept motivates the following three objections. According to a deontological conception of epistemic justification, one has an intellectual duty, requirement, or obligation to believe justifiably. Deontologists commonly hold that people are rightly praised for believing or blamed for failing to believe in accordance with this duty or obligation.

i. Ought Implies Can

Many believe that this deontological conception of epistemic justification entails that one ought to believe a proposition only if one can believe it. Put differently, one might think that one has to be able to believe p in order for one to be justified in believing p. (This second statement of the issue is more perspicuous, as I here set aside issues regarding doxastic voluntarism.) Some propositions are too complicated and complex for a given person to entertain given his or her actual abilities, and other propositions are too complex for humans to even possibly entertain. It seems wrong to say that one is justified in believing that these extremely complex propositions are true. (EVI), however, appears to imply that one can be justified in believing such extremely complex propositions, especially given the theories of evidence and evidential support sketched in section 2d. above. If, however, (EVI) does have this consequence, then one might conclude that evidentialism is false.

The argument here has two main premises. The first premise is that (EVI) entails that one can be justified in believing a proposition that it is impossible for one to entertain. The second premise is that if this first premise is true, then (EVI) is false. Because evidentialism neither rules out nor entails the motivating deontological conception of epistemic justification, evidentialists can plausibly deny either premise.

Standard accounts of evidentialism deny the first premise. According to these accounts, the proper nature of evidential support rules out the possibility that one’s evidence can support a proposition that one cannot entertain. Evidential support is, in this sense, restricted. Whether or not such evidentialist theories are acceptable depends crucially on whether evidentialism is able to accommodate this restriction in a principled way. Here evidentialists can appeal to meta-epistemological considerations regarding the nature of epistemic justification, as well as to intuitions about a sufficiently varied set of cases. For instance, the deontological conception of justification itself can motivate and help explain a companion deontological conception of evidential support. In addition, one can appeal to cases like Feldman’s logic student example (in section 3b. above) in order to illustrate how the notion of evidential support should be restricted. Together, these considerations can help to motivate one’s evidentialist theory. In this way, one can formulate a version of evidentialism that clearly does not have the consequence that one can be justified in believing a proposition that one cannot entertain.

By contrast, an evidentialist who rejects a deontological conception of justification may accept that one can be justified in believing propositions too complex even to consider and as a result may reject the second premise of the argument. Again, the theory of evidentialism itself allows this. This second response to the argument would need to be strengthened by considerations against the motivating deontological conception of epistemic justification, but considering these in this entry would take us too far astray. The crucial point to emphasize here is that evidentialism neither rules out nor entails this conception of epistemic justification, so both responses are consistent with the theory.

ii. An Evidence-Gathering Requirement

Some argue that the justification of a belief depends, at least in part, on the inquiry that led to the belief. Two ways this can get fleshed out are as follows. One might argue that only beliefs that result from “epistemically responsible behavior” can be justified. In order to be justified on such a view, one must not only follow one’s evidence but also gather evidence in an epistemically responsible way. Alternatively, one might argue that one is not justified in believing a proposition if one could have easily discovered (or should have discovered) evidence that defeated one’s present justification for it. Here, we focus primarily on the latter.

When developing evidentialism in his introductory textbook, Epistemology, Richard Feldman presents the following example.

A professor and his wife are going to the movies to see Star Wars, Episode 68. The professor has in his hand today’s newspaper which contains the listings of movies at the theater and their times. He remembers that yesterday’s paper said that Star Wars, Episode 68 was showing at 8:00. Knowing that movies usually show at the same time each day, he believes that it is showing today at 8:00 as well. He does not look in today’s paper. When they get to the theater, they discover that the movie started at 7:30. When they complain at the box office about the change, they are told that the correct time was listed in the newspaper today. The professor’s wife says that he should have looked in today’s paper and he was not justified in thinking it started at 8:00. (47)

The professor has good evidence to believe that the movie starts at 8:00, but the claim is that he is not justified in believing this because he should have (and could have very easily) gathered defeating evidence. Evidentialism does not take into account one’s evidence-gathering and, thus, cannot account for this intuition.

Evidentialism is a theory about the present justificatory status of propositions and beliefs for subjects. It provides an account of what one should now believe, given one’s actual situation. Feldman claims that this is the central epistemological question; it alone determines the justificatory status of one’s beliefs. There are other questions about when one ought to gather more evidence, but these, Feldman claims, should be carefully distinguished from questions regarding epistemic justification (Epistemology, 48). As it is, the professor is believing exactly as he ought to believe as he is driving to the theater. As a result, Feldman concludes, evidentialism provides the correct answer about this case.

iii. Duties Not to Follow One’s Evidence

The previous objection to evidentialism attempted to demonstrate that having evidence that supports believing p is not sufficient for being justified in believing p. One might also attempt to demonstrate this by providing examples that do not appeal to evidence gathering requirements. The following is one such example.

Suppose that Bill comes to possess overwhelming evidence that his recently deceased wife was having multiple affairs throughout their marriage. If he were to come to believe what his evidence supports, he would blame his children and himself. We can further suppose that he is presently so unstable as a result of his loss that believing that his wife was having affairs would cause him to seriously harm his children before committing suicide. In such a case, it is very clear that Bill ought not to believe that his wife was having affairs. Indeed, we might say that he has a duty not to believe exactly what his evidence supports. Since evidentialism implies that he really ought to believe that his wife was having affairs, evidentialism is false.

The standard response to these types of examples is to distinguish between different kinds of demands, oughts, and duties and to hold that sometimes these conflict. For example, we have an epistemic duty to follow our evidence, we have a practical duty to not always seek out more evidence for each of the propositions we consider, and we may also have moral duties to believe or disbelieve certain propositions. While these duties can conflict, nevertheless, the epistemic, moral, and practical demands on us remain. Thus, the response is that Bill does have an epistemic duty to believe what his evidence supports, even though he has overriding moral and prudential duties to believe that his wife was not having affairs. While this response is fairly uncontroversial, the crucial point to emphasize here is that such a move is itself a substantial thesis that is in need of support. We need to be shown in an independently motivated way why we should believe that matters should be understood in this way rather than in some other.

d. A Pragmatic Reply

William James has famously argued that having adequate evidence is not necessary for one to believe justifiably. James notes that our fears, hopes, and desires (in short, our “passions”) do influence what we believe. We do not proceed in conformance with Clifford’s evidentialist thesis, nor should we. Furthermore, when we are confronted with an option to do or not to do something, we cannot help but choose one or the other; the choice is forced. By failing to decide, we embrace one of the options. In such situations, it can be permissible for one to believe a proposition in the absence of sufficient evidence. More specifically, James argues that whenever we are confronted with a live, forced, momentous option to believe or not to believe a proposition that cannot be decided on “intellectual grounds” alone, it is permissible for us to decide on the basis of our “passional nature” (522).

Consider, for example, the proposition that God exists. Believing or failing to believe that God exists is a forced and momentous option. It is forced because we cannot help but choose one or the other; a failure to decide is, in effect, to choose to not believe that God exists. It is momentous since it is a unique opportunity to gain something supremely significant and only one of the options, belief, will deliver this supreme good. Contrary to the evidentialist, James argues that one can justifiably believe that God exists in the absence of supporting evidence if both believing that God exists and failing to believe that God exists are live options for one.

Here, again, evidentialists can respond by appealing to a distinction between different kinds of justification. One may be pragmatically or morally justified in believing against one’s evidence, but this is not to say that one is epistemically justified in so believing. For example, evidentialists can begin by noting that it is in some sense very reasonable to let our “passions” influence our actions and beliefs. It may be in one’s own interest to believe that one’s wife is not having an affair, for instance. We might put this point by saying that one is pragmatically justified in believing that one’s wife is not having an affair. Furthermore, the stakes might be so high that such pragmatic considerations outweigh any epistemic considerations we might have. Hence, even though one’s evidence does not support believing p (and one is therefore not epistemically justified in believing p), it may be, all things considered, more rational for one to believe p than to not believe p. Of course, nothing here turns on the content of the belief in question. Similar cases can be constructed for religious beliefs as well, and some evidentialists might want to focus on the particular nature of religious beliefs in order to directly respond to the religious case James considers. In summary, while it is true that non-epistemic considerations can outweigh epistemic considerations, the epistemic considerations remain. While it is not epistemically permissible to flout our evidentialist duties, we do think that in certain cases it is in some sense permissible to violate them. In this way, evidentialists can try to utilize a distinction between different kinds of justification in order to try to explain away the intuitions that appear to support James’ general thesis, as well as his claims about religious belief in particular.

e. Rationally Believing Skepticism is False

Keith DeRose has presented a more recent objection that has its roots in the philosophical challenge posed by skepticism. Two separate arguments are distinguishable here. First, DeRose argues that evidentialism appears unable to account for the degree to which he is justified in believing that particular skeptical scenarios are false (703-706). The specific argument DeRose presents makes reference to his contextualist intuitions. In the context of discussing theories of evidentialism in general, it is important to note this contextualist dimension of his argument, and I’ll make reference to it below.

DeRose thinks people are justified in believing, to a fairly substantial degree, that they are not brains in vats, and he thinks that any correct theory of epistemic justification must account for the substantial degree to which people are so justified in believing. In order to be an adequate theory of justification, therefore, evidentialism must show how the evidence people normally possess substantially supports believing that they are not brains in vats. DeRose claims that this has not yet been done, and he doubts that evidentialism can accomplish it adequately.

Second, DeRose claims that this difficulty highlights a fundamental complexity in the notion of evidence. In short, he thinks that at any given time we don’t have “one simple body of evidence that constitutes” the evidence that we have (704). For instance, it seems as though my belief that I have hands is evidence that I have and can use to support various other propositions—the proposition that I did not lose them in recent combat, for example. If, though, it is good evidence that I in fact have and can use, then it seems I should be able to appeal to it in order to argue that I am not a (handless) brain in a vat. It seems it should be uncontroversial that one’s evidence justifies one in believing that this skeptical scenario is false, yet justifying the denial of such skeptical scenarios is much more difficult than this implies. My belief that I have hands appears not to be able to justify the proposition that I am not a (handless) brain in a vat. In summary, when some issues are being discussed, my belief that I have hands is evidence I can appeal to, but when other issues are being discussed it appears not to be evidence that I can use. Evidentialism owes us an explanation of this.

As with most of the objections here considered, the force of DeRose’s points will vary with each proposed version of evidentialism. The central notions of evidence and evidential support do have to be explained, and they have to be explained in a way that allows reasonable conclusions about people’s typical appraisals of skeptical scenarios. As I have developed evidentialism in section 2 above, one can develop both contextualist and non-contextualist versions. This is especially important to note because exactly the sorts of considerations regarding skepticism DeRose invokes motivate contextualism in general and contextualist versions of evidentialism in particular. A contextualist version of evidentialism will hold that when skeptical scenarios are not being discussed, people are justified in believing to a very high degree that skeptical scenarios do not obtain. As a result, DeRose’s first argument is much more interesting and intuitively plausible when applied to non-contextualist versions of evidentialism.

The traditional responses to skepticism are exactly the responses that non-contextualist evidentialists have available. For example, non-contextualist evidentialists can utilize some closure principle or inference to the best explanation to try to account for the degree to which we think we are justified in believing that skeptical hypotheses are false. Whether these strategies succeed is controversial, but the problem of skepticism is a difficult and serious one, and no proposed solution is uncontroversial. It should be no surprise, then, that one may object to the consequences any version of evidentialism has for the skeptical challenge. The fundamental lesson here is that the evidentialist needs to develop these consequences and defend them.

The second of DeRose’s arguments is best understood as a demand for a fully developed and adequate theory of evidential support. We want to know how it is that evidence works so as to justify beliefs. This demand is wholly appropriate, of course, since evidence and evidential support are concepts central to evidentialism. On one standard account, I can appeal to the proposition that I have hands in order to come to believe justifiably that I did not lose them in combat precisely because I am justified in believing propositions about the external world (including, of course, the proposition that I have hands). Although, when one is trying to show how it is that one is justified in believing that one has hands, one obviously cannot appeal to the fact that one is justified in believing the proposition that one has hands. One needs to appeal to other propositions, propositions whose justification is prior to (or does not depend on) the justification of the proposition in question. All of this seems to be uncontroversial, but this is just to explain how evidence works so as to justify one in believing that certain propositions are true. The structure of justification is part of evidential support, and it is because some propositions are more basic than other propositions that we cannot appeal to those less basic propositions in order to justify the more basic ones. There is no unclarity here, but the explanation does help to illustrate why a response to DeRose’s first argument is so crucial. The story depends on one’s already being justified in believing some fundamental external world propositions. It is here that the evidentialist has to confront the skeptic and somehow explain how it is that we are justified in believing that skeptical hypotheses are false.

4. Conclusion

This brief treatment of evidentialism explains it as a type of theory of epistemic justification. All evidentialist theories are united in understanding justification as being a function of one’s present evidence as formalized in (EVI), yet many widely divergent options are available to one who seeks to develop the theory. There are competing ideas about which mental states count as evidence, different understandings of the notion of having evidence, various ways of understanding the crucial notion of support, and also various ways of relating these three central concepts. Many of the objections developed above apply only to some of these ways of developing the theory. This highlights the role they can play in one’s attempting to develop a complete evidentialist thesis. As is the case with theories in all areas of philosophy, objections such as those developed above help to guide philosophers towards more promising formulations of the theory. It remains to be seen whether evidentialism can be formulated in a way that not only overcomes each of these objections but also helps us to provide reasonable answers to other central epistemological questions.

5. References and Further Reading

W. K. Clifford. “The Ethics of Belief.” The Theory of Knowledge. 3rd. ed. Ed. Louis P. Pojman. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 2003. 515-518.
Cohen, Stewart. “How to be a Fallibilist.” Philosophical Perspectives, 2. Ed. James E. Tomberlin. Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Co., 1988. 91-123.
DeRose, Keith. “Ought We to Follow Our Evidence?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 60 (2000): 697-706.
Feldman, Richard. “Authoritarian Epistemology.” Philosophical Topics 23.1 (1995): 147-169.
Feldman, Richard. Epistemology. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Prentice Hall, 2003.
Feldman, Richard and Earl Conee. “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies 48 (1985): 15-34.
Goldman, Alvin. Epistemology and Cognition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1986.
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. 2nd ed. Ed. Eric Steinberg. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Co., 1993.
James, William. “The Will To Believe.” The Theory of Knowledge. 3rd. ed. Ed. Louis P. Pojman. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 2003. 519-526.
Plantinga, Alvin. “Reason and Belief in God.” Faith and Rationality. Eds. Alvin Plantinga and Nicholas Wolterstorff. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press: 1983. 16-93.
Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Russell, Bertrand. Human Knowledge: Its Scope and Limits. New York: Simon and Schuster, 1948.

a. More Advanced Studies

While this list in no way approximates comprehensiveness, the following are some additional helpful works on evidentialism in epistemology.

Conee, Earl and Richard Feldman. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2004.
- This is, perhaps, the best single work available for exploring these issues in more detail, and it is by all accounts an excellent place to start. It includes their article, “Evidentialism,” which has come to be viewed as the definitive article on the theory. It also contains other previously published articles that not only examine particular aspects of the theory but also defend favored versions as well as new, previously unpublished articles on the topic.
Feldman, Richard and Earl Conee. “Internalism Defended.” Epistemology: Internalism and Externalism. Ed. Hilary Kornblith. Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 2001. 231-260.
- Much that has been written on the internalism and externalism debate in epistemology is very relevant to evidentialism. I choose to include only one such article here. “Internalism Defended,” argues that evidentialism is one internalist theory of justification that is able to overcome all of the common objections raised to internalist theories of justification. Both a version of this paper and an “afterward” is included in Conee and Feldman’s book Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology.
Feldman, Richard. “Having Evidence.” Philosophical Analysis. Ed. David Austin. Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 1988. 83-104.
- This is a sustained examination of the crucial notion of having evidence. Feldman demonstrates just how vital it is, clearly lays out the complications and difficulties involved, and defends one particular interpretation. Reprinted with an “afterward” in Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology.
Haack, Susan. Evidence and Inquiry: Towards Reconstruction in Epistemology. Cambridge, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 1993.
- This is a sustained explication and defense of a novel evidentialist theory of the structure of epistemic justification. Haack terms this theory, “foundherentism,” as it blends elements of coherentism and foundationalism. This book is helpful reading for those who want to gain a more complete understanding of competing theories of the nature of evidential support.

Author Information

Daniel M. Mittag
Email: dlmt@mail.rochester.edu
University of Rochester
U. S. A.

Objectivity

The terms “objectivity” and “subjectivity,” in their modern usage, generally relate to a perceiving subject (normally a person) and a perceived or unperceived object. The object is something that presumably exists independent of the subject’s perception of it. In other words, the object would be there, as it is, even if no subject perceived it. Hence, objectivity is typically associated with ideas such as reality, truth and reliability.

The perceiving subject can either perceive accurately or seem to perceive features of the object that are not in the object. For example, a perceiving subject suffering from jaundice could seem to perceive an object as yellow when the object is not actually yellow. Hence, the term “subjective” typically indicates the possibility of error.

The potential for discrepancies between features of the subject’s perceptual impressions and the real qualities of the perceived object generates philosophical questions. There are also philosophical questions regarding the nature of objective reality and the nature of our so-called subjective reality. Consequently, we have various uses of the terms “objective” and “subjective” and their cognates to express possible differences between objective reality and subjective impressions. Philosophers refer to perceptual impressions themselves as being subjective or objective. Consequent judgments are objective or subjective to varying degrees, and we divide reality into objective reality and subjective reality. Thus, it is important to distinguish the various uses of the terms “objective” and “subjective.”

Terminology
Epistemological Issues
Metaphysical Issues
Objectivity in Ethics
Major Historical Philosophical Theories of Objective Reality
References and Further Reading

1. Terminology

Many philosophers would use the term “objective reality” to refer to anything that exists as it is independent of any conscious awareness of it (via perception, thought, etc.). Common mid-sized physical objects presumably apply, as do persons having subjective states. Subjective reality would then include anything depending upon some (broadly construed) conscious awareness of it to exist. Particular instances of colors and sounds (as they are perceived) are prime examples of things that exist only when there are appropriate conscious states. Particular instances of emotions (e.g., my present happiness) also seem to be a subjective reality, existing when one feels them, and ceasing to exist when one’s mood changes.

“Objective knowledge” can simply refer to knowledge of an objective reality. Subjective knowledge would then be knowledge of any subjective reality.

There are, however, other uses of the terminology related to objectivity. Many philosophers use the term “subjective knowledge” to refer only to knowledge of one’s own subjective states. Such knowledge is distinguished from one’s knowledge of another individual’s subjective states and from knowledge of objective reality, which would both be objective knowledge under the present definitions. Your knowledge of another person’s subjective states can be called objective knowledge since it is presumably part of the world that is “object” for you, just as you and your subjective states are part of the world that is “object” for the other person.

This is a prominent distinction in epistemology (the philosophical study of knowledge) because many philosophers have maintained that subjective knowledge in this sense has a special status. They assert, roughly, that knowledge of one’s own subjective states is direct, or immediate, in a way that knowledge of anything else is not. It is convenient to refer to knowledge of one’s own subjective states simply as subjective knowledge. Following this definition, objective knowledge would be knowledge of anything other than one’s own subjective states.

One last prominent style of usage for terms related to objectivity deals with the nature of support a particular knowledge-claim has. “Objective knowledge” can designate a knowledge-claim having, roughly, the status of being fully supported or proven. Correspondingly, “subjective knowledge” might designate some unsupported or weakly supported knowledge-claim. It is more accurate to refer to these as objective and subjective judgments, rather than knowledge, but one should be on guard for the use of the term “knowledge” in this context. This usage fits with the general connotation for the term “objectivity” of solidity, trustworthiness, accuracy, impartiality, etc. The general connotation for many uses of “subjectivity” includes unreliability, bias, an incomplete (personal) perspective, etc.

“Objective judgment or belief” refers to a judgment or belief based on objectively strong supporting evidence, the sort of evidence that would be compelling for any rational being. A subjective judgment would then seem to be a judgment or belief supported by evidence that is compelling for some rational beings (subjects) but not compelling for others. It could also refer to a judgment based on evidence that is of necessity available only to some subjects.

These are the main uses for the terminology within philosophical discussions. Let’s examine some of the main epistemological issues regarding objectivity, presuming the aforementioned definitions of “objective reality” and “subjective reality.”

2. Epistemological Issues

a. Can We Know Objective Reality?

The subjective is characterized primarily by perceiving mind. The objective is characterized primarily by physical extension in space and time. The simplest sort of discrepancy between subjective judgment and objective reality is well illustrated by John Locke’s example of holding one hand in ice water and the other hand in hot water for a few moments. When one places both hands into a bucket of tepid water, one experiences competing subjective experiences of one and the same objective reality. One hand feels it as cold, the other feels it as hot. Thus, one perceiving mind can hold side-by-side clearly differing impressions of a single object. From this experience, it seems to follow that two different perceiving minds could have clearly differing impressions of a single object. That is, two people could put their hands into the bucket of water, one describing it as cold, the other describing it as hot. Or, more plausibly, two people could step outside, one describing the weather as chilly, the other describing it as pleasant.

We confront, then, an epistemological challenge to explain whether, and if so how, some subjective impressions can lead to knowledge of objective reality. A skeptic can contend that our knowledge is limited to the realm of our own subjective impressions, allowing us no knowledge of objective reality as it is in itself.

b. Does Agreement Among Subjects Indicate Objective Knowledge?

Measurement is allegedly a means to reach objective judgments, judgments having at least a high probability of expressing truth regarding objective reality. An objective judgment regarding the weather, in contrast to the competing subjective descriptions, would describe it as, say, 20°C (68°F). This judgment results from use of a measuring device. It is unlikely that the two perceiving subjects, using functioning thermometers, would have differing judgments about the outside air.

The example of two people giving differing reports about the weather (e.g., “chilly” vs. “pleasant”) illustrates that variation in different subjects’ judgments is a possible indicator of the subjectivity of their judgments. Agreement in different subjects’ judgments (20°C) is often taken to be indicative of objectivity. Philosophers commonly call this form of agreement “intersubjective agreement.” Does intersubjective agreement prove that there is objective truth? No, because having two or three or more perceiving subjects agreeing, for example, that it is very cold does not preclude the possibility of another perceiving subject claiming that it is not at all cold. Would we have a high likelihood of objective truth if we had intersubjective agreement among a large number of subjects? This line of reasoning seems promising, except for another observation from Locke about the possible discrepancies between subjective impressions and objective reality.

c. Primary and Secondary Qualities: Can We Know Primary Qualities?

According to Locke’s distinction between primary and secondary qualities, some of our subjective impressions do not correspond to any objective reality in the thing perceived. Our perception of sound, for example, is nothing like the actual physical vibrations that we know are the real cause of our subjective experience. Our perception of color is nothing like the complex combinations of various frequencies of electromagnetic radiation that we know cause our perception of color. Locke asserts that we can, through science, come to know what primary characteristics the object has in itself. Science teaches us, he says, that sound as we perceive it is not in the object itself whereas spatial dimensions, mass, duration, motion, etc. are in the object itself.

In response to this point, one can assert that, through science, we discover that those subjective impressions corresponding to nothing in the object are nonetheless caused by the truly objective features of the object. Thus, Locke’s approach leads to optimism regarding objective knowledge, i.e., knowledge of how things are independent of our perceptions of them.

d. Skepticism Regarding Knowledge of Objective Reality

In response to Locke’s line of thinking, Immanuel Kant used the expression “Ding an sich” (the “thing-in-itself”) to designate pure objectivity. The Ding an sich is the object as it is in itself, independent of the features of any subjective perception of it. While Locke was optimistic about scientific knowledge of the true objective (primary) characteristics of things, Kant, influenced by skeptical arguments from David Hume, asserted that we can know nothing regarding the true nature of the Ding an sich, other than that it exists. Scientific knowledge, according to Kant, is systematic knowledge of the nature of things as they appear to us subjects rather than as they are in themselves.

Using Kant’s distinction, intersubjective agreement would seem to be not only the best evidence we can have of objective truth but constitutive of objective truth itself. (This might require a theoretically perfect intersubjective agreement under ideal conditions.) Starting from the assumption that we can have knowledge only of things as they appear in subjective experience, the only plausible sense for the term “objective” would be judgments for which there is universal intersubjective agreement, or just for which there is necessarily universal agreement. If, alternately, we decide to restrict the term “objective” to the Ding an sich, there would be, according to Kant, no objective knowledge. The notion of objectivity thus becomes useless, perhaps even meaningless (for, say, a verificationist).

Facing any brand of skepticism regarding knowledge of objective reality in any robust sense, we should note that the notion of there being an objective reality is independent of any particular assertion about our prospects for knowing that reality in any objective sense. One should, in other words, agree that the idea of some objective reality, existing as it is independent of any subjective perception of it, apparently makes sense even for one who holds little hope for any of us knowing that there is such a reality, or knowing anything objectively about such a reality. Perhaps our human situation is such that we cannot know anything beyond our experiences; perhaps we are, each one of us individually, confined to the theater of our own minds. Nonetheless, we can conceive what it means to assert an objective reality beyond the stream of our experiences.

e. Defending Objective Knowledge

Opposing skepticism regarding objective reality, it is conceivable that there are “markers” of some sort in our subjective experiences distinguishing the reliable perceptions of objective truth from the illusions generated purely subjectively (hallucinations, misperceptions, perceptions of secondary qualities, etc.). Descartes, for example, wrote of “clear and distinct impressions” as having an inherent mark, as it were, attesting to their reliability as indicators of how things are objectively. This idea does not have many defenders today, however, since Descartes asserted certainty for knowledge derived from clear and distinct ideas. More acceptable among philosophers today would be a more modest assertion of a high likelihood of reliability for subjective impressions bearing certain marks. The marks of reliable impressions are not “clear and distinct” in Descartes’ sense, but have some connection to common sense ideas about optimal perceptual circumstances. Thus, defenders of objective knowledge are well advised to search for subjectively accessible “marks” on impressions that indicate a high likelihood of truth.

A defender of the prospects for objective knowledge would apparently want also to give some significance to intersubjective agreement. Assertions of intersubjective agreement are based, of course, on one’s subjective impressions of other perceiving subjects agreeing with one’s own judgments. Thus, intersubjective agreement is just one type of “mark” one might use to identify the more likely reliable impressions. This is simple common-sense. We have much more confidence in our judgments (or should, anyway) when they are shared by virtually everyone with whom we discuss them than when others (showing every sign of normal perceptual abilities and a sane mind) disagree. A central assumption behind this common pattern of thought, however, is that there are indeed many other perceiving subjects besides ourselves and we are all capable, sometimes at least, of knowing objective reality. Another assumption is that objective reality is logically consistent. Assuming that reality is consistent, it follows that your and my logically incompatible judgments about a thing cannot both be true; intersubjective disagreement indicates error for at least one of us. One can also argue that agreement indicates probable truth, because it is unlikely that you and I would both be wrong in our judgment regarding an object and both be wrong in exactly the same way. Conversely, if we were both wrong about some object, it is likely that we would have differing incorrect judgments about it, since there are innumerable ways for us to make a wrong judgment about an object.

f. Is There No Escape From the Subjective?

Despite plausible ways of arguing that intersubjective disagreement indicates error and agreement indicates some probability of truth, defenses of objective knowledge all face the philosophically daunting challenge of providing a cogent argument showing that any purported “mark” of reliability (including apparent intersubjective agreement) actually does confer a high likelihood of truth. The task seems to presuppose some method of determining objective truth in the very process of establishing certain sorts of subjective impressions as reliable indicators of truth. That is, we require some independent (non-subjective) way of determining which subjective impressions support knowledge of objective reality before we can find subjectively accessible “markers” of the reliable subjective impressions. What could such a method be, since every method of knowledge, judgment, or even thought seems quite clearly to go on within the realm of subjective impressions? One cannot get out of one’s subjective impressions, it seems, to test them for reliability. The prospects for knowledge of the objective world are hampered by our essential confinement within subjective impressions.

3. Metaphysical Issues

In metaphysics, i.e., the philosophical study of the nature of reality, the topic of objectivity brings up philosophical puzzles regarding the nature of the self, for a perceiving subject is also, according to most metaphysical theories, a potential object of someone else’s perceptions. Further, one can perceive oneself as an object, in addition to knowing one’s subjective states fairly directly. The self, then, is known both as subject and as object. Knowledge of self as subject seems to differ significantly from knowledge of the self as object.

The differences are most markedly in evidence in the philosophy of mind. Philosophers of mind try to reconcile, in some sense, what we know about the mind objectively and what we know subjectively. Observing minded beings as objects is central to the methods of psychology, sociology, and the sciences of the brain. Observing one minded being from the subjective point of view is something we all do, and it is central to our ordinary notions of the nature of mind. A fundamental problem for the philosophy of mind is to explain how any object, no matter how complex, can give rise to mind as we know it from the subjective point of view. That is, how can mere “stuff” give rise to the rich complexity of consciousness as we experience it? It seems quite conceivable that there be creatures exactly like us, when seen as objects, but having nothing like our conscious sense of ourselves as subjects. So there is the question of why we do have subjective conscious experience and how that comes to be. Philosophers also struggle to explain what sort of relationship might obtain between mind as we see it embodied objectively and mind as we experience it subjectively. Are there cause-and-effect relationships, for example, and how do they work?

The topic of seeing others and even oneself as an object in the objective world is a metaphysical issue, but it brings up an ethical issue regarding the treatment of persons. There are, in addition, special philosophical issues regarding assertions of objectivity in ethics.

4. Objectivity in Ethics

a. Persons in Contrast to Objects

First, the dual nature of persons as both subjects (having subjective experience) and objects within objective reality relates to one of the paramount theories of ethics in the history of philosophy. Immanuel Kant’s ethics gives a place of central importance to respect for persons. One formulation of his highly influential Categorical Imperative relates to the dual nature of persons. This version demands that one “treat humanity, in your own person or in the person of any other, never simply as a means, but always at the same time as an end” (Groundwork, p. 96). One may treat a mere object simply as a means to an end; one may use a piece of wood, for example, simply as a means of repairing a fence. A person, by contrast, is marked by subjectivity, having a subjective point of view, and has a special moral status according to Kant. Every person must be regarded as an end, that is as having intrinsic value. It seems that the inherent value of a person depends essentially on the fact that a person has a subjective conscious life in addition to objective existence.

This ethical distinction brings out an aspect of the term “object” as a “mere object,” in contrast to the subjectivity of a person. The term “objectivity” in this context can signify the mere “object-ness” of something at its moral status.

Despite widespread agreement that being a person with a subjective point of view has a special moral status, there is a general difficulty explaining whether this alleged fact, like all alleged moral facts, is an objective fact in any sense. It is also difficult to explain how one can know moral truths if they are indeed objective.

b. Objectivism, Subjectivism and Non-Cognitivism

Philosophical theories about the nature of morality generally divide into assertions that moral truths express subjective states and assertions that moral truths express objective facts, analogous to the fact, for example, that the sun is more massive than the earth.

So-called subjectivist theories regard moral statements as declaring that certain facts hold, but the facts expressed are facts about a person’s subjective states. For example, the statement “It is wrong to ignore a person in distress if you are able to offer aid” just means something like “I find it offensive when someone ignores a person in distress….” This is a statement about the subject’s perceptions of the object, not about the object itself (that is, ignoring a person in distress). Objectivist theories, in contrast, regard the statement “It is wrong to ignore….” as stating a fact about the ignoring itself.

Subjectivist theories do not have to regard moral statements as statements about a single subject’s perceptions or feelings. A subjectivist could regard the statement “Torture is immoral,” for example, as merely expressing the feeling of abhorrence among members of a certain culture, or among people in general.

In addition to objectivism and subjectivism, a third major theory of morality called non-cognitivism asserts that alleged moral statements do not make any claim about any reality, either subjective or objective. This approach asserts that alleged moral statements are just expressions of subjective feelings; they are not reports about such feelings. Thus the statement “Torture is immoral” is equivalent to wincing or saying “ugh” at the thought of torture, rather than describing your feelings about torture.

c. Objectivist Theories

Among objectivist theories of morality, the most straightforward version declares that is it an objective fact, for example, that it is wrong to ignore a person in distress if you are able to offer aid. This sort of theory asserts that the wrongness of such behavior is part of objective reality in the same way that the sun’s being more massive than the earth is part of objective reality. Both facts would obtain regardless of whether any conscious being ever came to know either of them.

Other objectivist theories of morality try to explain the widespread feeling that there is an important difference between moral assertions and descriptive, factual assertions while maintaining that both types of assertion are about something other than mere subjective states. Such theories compare moral assertions to assertions about secondary qualities. The declaration that a certain object is green is not merely a statement about a person’s subjective state. It makes an assertion about how the object is, but it’s an assertion that can be formulated only in relation to the states of perceiving subjects under the right conditions. Thus, determining whether an object is green depends essentially on consulting the considered judgments of appropriately placed perceivers. Being green, by definition, implies the capacity to affect perceiving humans under the right conditions in certain ways. By analogy, moral assertions can be assertions about how things objectively are while depending essentially on consulting the considered judgments of appropriately placed perceivers. Being morally wrong implies, on this view, the capacity to affect perceiving humans under the right conditions in certain ways.

d. Can We Know Moral Facts?

For either sort of objectivist approach to morality, it is difficult to explain how people come to know the moral properties of things. We seem not to be able to know the moral qualities of things through ordinary sense experience, for example, because the five senses seem only to tell us how things are in the world, not how they ought to be. Nor can we reason from the way things are to the way they ought to be, since, as David Hume noted, “is” does not logically imply an “ought.” Some philosophers, including Hume, have postulated that we have a special mode of moral perception, analogous to but beyond the five ordinary senses, which gives us knowledge of moral facts. This proposal is controversial, since it presents problems for verifying moral perceptions and resolving moral disputes. It is also problematic as long as it provides no account of how moral perception works. By contrast, we have a good understanding of the mechanisms underlying our perception of secondary qualities such as greenness.

Many people assert that it is much less common to get widespread agreement on moral judgments than on matters of observable, measurable facts. Such an assertion seems to be an attempt to argue that moral judgments are not objective based on lack of intersubjective agreement about them. Widespread disagreement does not, however, indicate that there is no objective fact to be known. There are many examples of widespread disagreement regarding facts that are clearly objective. For example, there was once widespread disagreement about whether the universe is expanding or in a “steady state.” That disagreement did not indicate that there is no objective fact concerning the state of the universe. Thus, widespread disagreement regarding moral judgments would not, by itself, indicate that there are no objective moral facts.

This assertion is apparently an attempt to modify the inference from widespread intersubjective agreement to objective truth. If so, it is mistaken. Assuming that the inference from intersubjective agreement to probable objective truth is strong, it does not follow that one can infer from lack of intersubjective agreement to probable subjectivity. As previously indicated, intersubjective disagreement logically supports the assertion that there is an error in at least one of the conflicting judgments, but it does not support an assertion of the mere subjectivity of the matter being judged. Further, the vast areas of near-universal agreement in moral judgments typically receives too little attention in discussions of the nature of morality. There are seemingly innumerable moral judgments (e.g., it is wrong to needlessly inflict pain on a newborn baby) that enjoy nearly universal agreement across cultures and across time periods. This agreement should, at least prima facie, support an assertion to objectivity as it does for, say, judgments about the temperature outside.

5. Major Historical Philosophical Theories of Objective Reality

Any serious study of the nature of objectivity and objective knowledge should examine the central metaphysical and epistemological positions of history’s leading philosophers, as well as contemporary contributions. The following very brief survey should give readers some idea of where to get started.

Plato is famous for a distinctive view of objective reality. He asserted roughly that the greatest reality was not in the ordinary physical objects we sense around us, but in what he calls Forms, or Ideas. (The Greek term Plato uses resembles the word “idea,” but it is preferable to call them Forms, for they are not ideas that exist only in a mind, as is suggested in our modern usage of the term “idea.”) Ordinary objects of our sense experience are real, but the Forms are a “higher reality,” according to Plato. Having the greatest reality, they are the only truly objective reality, we could say.

Forms are most simply described as the pure essences of things, or the defining characteristics of things. We see many varied instances of chairs around us, but the essence of what it is to be a chair is the Form “chair.” Likewise, we see many beautiful things around us, but the Form “beauty” is the “what it is to be beautiful.” The Form is simply whatever it is that sets beautiful things apart from everything else.

In epistemology, Plato accordingly distinguishes the highest knowledge as knowledge of the highest reality, the Forms. Our modern usage of the terms “objective knowledge” and “objective reality” seem to fit in reasonably well here.

Aristotle, by contrast, identifies the ordinary objects of sense experience as the most objective reality. He calls them “primary substance.” The forms of things he calls “secondary substance.” Hence, Aristotle’s metaphysics seems to fit better than Plato’s with our current understanding of objective reality, but his view of objective knowledge differs somewhat. For him, objective knowledge is knowledge of the forms, or essences, of things. We can know individual things objectively, but not perfectly. We can know individuals only during occurrent perceptual contact with them, but we can know forms perfectly, or timelessly.

Descartes famously emphasized that subjective reality is better known than objective reality, but knowledge of the objective reality of one’s own existence as a non-physical thinking thing is nearly as basic, or perhaps as basic, as one’s knowledge of the subjective reality of one’s own thinking. For Descartes, knowledge seems to start with immediate, indubitable knowledge of one’s subjective states and proceeds to knowledge of one’s objective existence as a thinking thing. Cogito, ergo sum (usually translated as “I think, therefore I am”) expresses this knowledge. All knowledge of realities other than oneself ultimately rests on this immediate knowledge of one’s own existence as a thinking thing. One’s existence as a non-physical thinking thing is an objective existence, but it appears that Descartes infers this existence from the subjective reality of his own thinking. The exact interpretation of his famous saying is still a matter of some controversy, however, and it may not express an inference at all.

We have already looked at some of John Locke’s most influential assertions about the nature of objective reality. Bishop Berkeley followed Locke’s empiricism in epistemology, but put forth a markedly different view of reality. Berkeley’s Idealism asserts that the only realities are minds and mental contents. He does, however, have a concept of objective reality. A table, for example, exists objectively in the mind of God. God creates objective reality by thinking it and sustains any objective reality, such as the table, only so long as he continues to think of it. Thus the table exists objectively for us, not just as a fleeting perception, but as the totality of all possible experiences of it. My particular experience of it at this moment is a subjective reality, but the table as an objective reality in the mind of God implies a totality of all possible experiences of it. Berkeley asserts there is no need to postulate some physical substance underlying all those experiences to be the objective reality of the table; the totality of possible experiences is adequate.

We have looked briefly at some of Kant’s claims about the nature of objective reality. More recent philosophy continues these discussions in many directions, some denying objectivity altogether. Detailed discussion of these movements goes beyond the purview of this essay, but interested readers should specially investigate Hegel’s idealism, as well as succeeding schools of thought such as phenomenology, existentialism, logical positivism, pragmatism, deconstructionism, and post-modernism. The philosophy of mind, naturally, also continually confronts basic questions of subjectivity and objectivity.

6. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. “Yes, Virginia, There is a Real World.” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association 52 (1979): 779-808.
Descartes, Rene. Meditations (1641). In The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, eds. J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff and D. Murdoch (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1975).
Kant, Immanuel. Prolegomena to any Future Metaphysics (1783). Trans. James W. Ellington (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1977).
Locke, John. Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1689). Ed. Peter Nidditch (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975).
Moser, Paul. Philosophy After Objectivity. (New York: Oxford University Press, 1993).
Nagel, Thomas. The View From Nowhere. (New York: Oxford University Press, 1986).
Quine, W. V. Word and Object. (Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1960).
Rorty, Richard. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1979).
Rorty, Richard. Objectivity, Relativism, and Truth: Philosophical Papers, Vol. 1. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991).
Wright, Crispin. Realism, Meaning, and Truth. (Oxford: Blackwell, 1987).

Author Information

Dwayne H. Mulder
Email: mulderd@sonoma.edu
Sonoma State University
U. S. A.

Zhuangzi (Chuang-Tzu, 369—298 B.C.E.)

The Zhuangzi (also known in Wade-Giles romanization romanization as Chuang-tzu), named after “Master Zhuang” was, along with the Laozi, one of the earliest texts to contribute to the philosophy that has come to be known as Daojia, or School of the Way. According to traditional dating, Master Zhuang, to whom the first seven chapters of the text have traditionally been attributed, was an almost exact contemporary of the Confucian thinker Mencius, but we have no record of direct philosophical dialogue between them. The text is ranked among the greatest of literary and philosophical masterpieces that China has produced. Its style is complex—mythical, poetic, narrative, humorous, indirect, and polysemic.

Much of the text espouses a holistic philosophy of life, encouraging disengagement from the artificialities of socialization, and cultivation of our natural “ancestral” potencies and skills, in order to live a simple and natural, but full and flourishing life. It is critical of our ordinary categorizations and evaluations, noting the multiplicity of different modes of understanding between different creatures, cultures, and philosophical schools, and the lack of an independent means of making a comparative evaluation. It advocates a mode of understanding that is not committed to a fixed system, but is fluid and flexible, and that maintains a provisional, pragmatic attitude towards the applicability of these categories and evaluations.

The Zhuangzi text is an anthology, in which several distinctive strands of Daoist thought can be recognized. The Jin dynasty thinker and commentator, Guo Xiang (Kuo Hsiang, d. 312 CE), edited and arranged an early collection, and reduced what had been a work in fifty-two chapters down to thirty-three chapters, excising material that he considered to be repetitious or spurious. The versions of Daoist philosophy expressed in this text were highly influential in the reception, interpretation, and transformation of Buddhist philosophies in China.

Historical Background
The Zhuangzi Text
Central Concepts in the “Inner Chapters”
Key Interpreters of Zhuangzi
References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

According to the Han dynasty historian, Sima Qian, Zhuangzi was born during the Warring States (403-221 BCE), more than a century after the death of Confucius. During this time, the ostensibly ruling house of Zhou had lost its authority, and there was increasing violence between states contending for imperial power. This situation gave birth to the phenomenon known as the baijia, the hundred schools: the flourishing of many schools of thought, each articulating its own conception of a return to a state of harmony. The first and most significant of these schools was that of Confucius, who became the chief representative of the Ruists (Confucians), the scholars and propagators of the wisdom and culture of the tradition. Their great rivals were the Mohists, the followers of Mozi (“Master Mo”), who were critical of what they perceived to be the elitism and extravagance of the traditional culture. The archaeological discovery at Guo Dian in 1993 of an early Laozi manuscript suggests that the philosophical movement associated with the text also began to emerge during this period. The strands of Daoist philosophy expressed in the earliest strata of the Zhuangzi developed within a context infused with the ideas of these three schools. Master Zhuang is usually taken to be the author of the first seven chapters, but in recent years a few scholars have found reason to be skeptical not just of his authorship of any of the text, but also of his very existence.

According to early evidence compiled by Sima Qian, Zhuangzi was born in a village called Meng, in the state of Song; according to Lu Deming, the Sui-Tang dynasty scholar, the Pu River in which Zhuangzi was said to have fished was in the state of Chen which, as Wang Guowei points out, had become a territory of the southern state of Chu. We might say that Zhuangzi was situated in the borderlands between Chu, centered around the Yangzi River, and the central plains—which centered around the Yellow River and which were the home of the Shang and Zhou cultures. Some scholars, especially in China, maintain that there is a connection between the philosophies of the Daoist texts and the culture of Chu. The diversity of regions and cultures in early China has increasingly been acknowledged, and most interest has been directed to the state of Chu, in large part because of the wealth of archaeological evidence that is being unearthed there. As one develops a sensitivity for the culture of Chu, one senses deep resonances with the aesthetic sensibility of the Daoists, and with Zhuangzi’s style in particular. The silks and bronzes of Chu, for example, are rich and vibrant; the patterns and images on fabrics and pottery are fanciful and naturalistic. However, while the evidence is persuasive, it is far from decisive.

If the traditional dating is reliable, then Zhuangzi would have been an almost exact contemporary of the Ruist thinker Mencius, though there is no clear evidence of communication between them. There are a few remarks in the Zhuangzi that could possibly be alluding to Mencius’ philosophy, but there is nothing in the Mencius that shows any interest in Zhuangzi. The philosopher and statesman Hui Shi, or Huizi (“Master Hui,” 380-305 BCE), is represented as a close friend of Zhuangzi, though decidedly unconvinced by his philosophical musings. There appears to have been a friendly rivalry between the broad and mythic-minded Zhuangzi and the politically motivated Huizi, who is critiqued in the text as a shortsighted paradox-monger. Despite their very deep philosophical distance, and Huizi’s perceived limitations, Zhuangzi expresses great appreciation both for his linguistic abilities and for his friendship. The other “logician,” Gongsun Longzi, would also have been a contemporary of Zhuangzi, and although Zhuangzi does not, unfortunately, engage in any direct philosophical discussion with him, one does find what appears to be an occasional wink in his direction.

2. The Zhuangzi Text

The currently extant text known as the Zhuangzi is the result of the editing and arrangement of the Jin dynasty thinker and commentator Guo Xiang (Kuo Hsiang, d. 312 CE). He reduced what was then a work in fifty-two chapters to the current edition of thirty-three chapters, excising material that he considered to be spurious. His commentary on the text provides an interpretation that has been one of the most influential over the subsequent centuries.

Guo Xiang’s thirty-three chapter edition of the text is divided into three collections, known as the Inner Chapters (Neipian), the Outer Chapters (Waipian), and the Miscellaneous Chapters (Zapian). The Inner Chapters are the first seven chapters and are generally considered to be the work of Zhuangzi himself. Because the evidence for this attribution is sparse and because of the miscellaneous nature of the editing, some scholars (McCraw, Klein) express skepticism that we can be sure which were the earliest passages or who they were written by. The Outer Chapters are chapters 8 to 22, and the Miscellaneous Chapters are chapters 23 to 33. The Outer and Miscellaneous Chapters can be further subdivided into different strands of Daoist thought. Much modern research has been devoted to a sub-classification of these chapters according to philosophical school. Kuan Feng made some scholarly breakthroughs early in the twentieth century; A. C. Graham continued his classification in the tradition of Kuan Feng. Harold Roth has also taken up a consideration of this issue and come up with some very interesting results. What follows is a simplified version of the results of the research of Liu Xiaogan.

According to Liu, chapters 17 to 27 and 32 can be considered to be the work of a school of Zhuangzi’s followers, what he calls the Shu Zhuang Pai, or the “Transmitter” school. Graham, following Kuan Feng, considers chapters 22 to 27 and 32 not to be coherent chapters, but merely random “ragbag” collections of fragments. In fact, this miscellaneous character is characteristic of many, if not most, of the rest of the chapters, and complicates any simplistic classification of chapters as a whole. Liu considers chapters 8 to 10, chapters 28 to 31, and the first part of chapter 11 to be from a school of Anarchists whose philosophy is closely related to that of Laozi. Graham, again following Kuan Feng, sees these as two separate but related schools: the first he attributes to a writer he calls the “Primitivist,” the second he considers to be a school of followers of Yang Zhu. Liu classifies chapters 12 to 16, chapter 33, and the first part of chapter 11 as belonging to the Han dynasty school known as Huang-Lao. Graham refers to them as the Syncretist chapters. Graham finds the classification of chapter 16 to be problematic. Chapter 30 does not seem to have any distinctively Daoist content at all. Though Graham thinks that it is consistent with the Yangist emphasis on preserving life, it is also consistent with Confucian and Mohist critiques of aggression.

In the following chart the further to the right the chapters are listed, the further away they are from the central ideas of the Zhuangzian philosophy of the Inner Chapters:

The Inner Chapters	School of Zhuang	Anarchist Utopianism	Huang-Lao Syncretism

1. Wandering Beyond	17. Autumn Floods	8. Webbed Toes	11. Let it Be, Leave it Alone
2. Discussion on Smoothing Things Out	18. Utmost Happiness	9. Horse’s Hooves	12. Heaven and Earth
3. The Principle of Nurturing Life	19. Mastering Life	10. Rifling Trunks	13. The Way of Heaven
4. In the Human Realm	20. The Mountain Tree	11. Let it Be, Leave it Alone	14. The Turning of Heaven
5. Signs of Abundant Potency	21. Tian Zi Fang		15. Constrained in Will
6. The Vast Ancestral Teacher	22. Knowledge Wandered North	(16?. Mending the Inborn Nature)	(16?. Mending the Inborn Nature)
7. Responding to Emperors and Kings	23. Geng Sang Chu
	24. Xu Wugui	28. Yielding the Throne	33. The World
	25. Ze Yang	29. Robber Zhi
	26. External Things	(30. Discoursing on Swords?)
	27. Imputed Words	31. The Old Fisherman
	32. Lie Yukou

3. Central Concepts in the “Inner Chapters”

The following is an account of the central ideas of Zhuangzian philosophy, going successively through each of the seven Inner Chapters. This discussion is not confined to the content of the particular chapters, but rather represents a fuller articulation of the inter-relationships of the ideas between the Inner Chapters, and also between these ideas and those expressed in the Outer and Miscellaneous Chapters, where these appear to be related. References to “Zhuangzi” below should not be taken as referring to a historical person, but rather as shorthand for the overall philosophy as articulated in the text of the Inner Chapters and related passages.

a. Chapter 1: Xiao Yao You (Wandering Beyond)

The title of the first chapter of the Zhuangzi has also been translated as “Free and Easy Wandering” and “Going Rambling Without a Destination.” Both of these reflect the sense of the Daoist who is in spontaneous accord with the natural world, and who has retreated from the anxieties and dangers of social life, in order to live a healthy and peaceful natural life. In modern Mandarin, the word xiaoyao has thus come to mean “free, at ease, leisurely, spontaneous.” It conveys the impression of people who have given up the hustle and bustle of worldly existence and have retired to live a leisurely life outside the city, perhaps in the natural setting of the mountains.

But this everyday expression is lacking a deeper significance that is expressed in the classical Chinese phrase: the sense of distance, or going beyond. As with all Zhuangzi’s images, this is to be understood metaphorically. The second word, ‘yao,’ means ‘distance’ or ‘beyond,’ and here implies going beyond the boundaries of familiarity. We ordinarily confine ourselves within our social roles, expectations, and values, and with our everyday understandings of things. But this, according to Zhuangzi, is inadequate for a deeper appreciation of the natures of things, and for a more successful mode of interacting with them. We need at the very least to undo preconceptions that prevent us from seeing things and events in new ways; we need to see how we can structure and restructure the boundaries of things. But we can only do so when we ourselves have ‘wandered beyond’ the boundaries of the familiar. It is only by freeing our imaginations to reconceive ourselves, and our worlds, and the things with which we interact, that we may begin to understand the deeper tendencies of the natural transformations by which we are all affected, and of which we are all constituted. By loosening the bonds of our fixed preconceptions, we bring ourselves closer to an attunement to the potent and productive natural way (dao) of things.

Paying close attention to the textual associations, we see that wandering is associated with the word wu, ordinarily translated ‘nothing,’ or ‘without.’ Related associations include: wuyou (no ‘something’) and wuwei (no interference). Roger Ames and David Hall have commented extensively on these wu expressions. Most importantly, they are not to be understood as simple negations, but have a much more complex function. The significance of all of these expressions must be traced back to the wu of Laozi: a type of negation that does not simply negate, but places us in a new kind of relation to ‘things’—a phenomenological waiting that allows them to manifest, one that acknowledges the space that is the possibility of their coming to presence, one that appreciates the emptiness that is the condition of the possibility of their capacity to function, to be useful (as the hollow inside a house makes it useful for living). The behavior of one who wanders beyond becomes wuwei: sensitive and responsive without fixed preconceptions, without artifice, responding spontaneously in accordance with the unfolding of the inter-developing factors of the environment of which one is an inseparable part.

But it is not just the crossing of horizontal boundaries that is at stake. There is also the vertical distance that is important: one rises to a height from which formerly important distinctions lose what appeared to be their crucial significance. Thus arises the distinction between the great and the small, or the Vast (da) and the petty (xiao). Of this distinction Zhuangzi says that the petty cannot come up to the Vast: petty understanding that remains confined and defined by its limitations cannot match Vast understanding, the expansive understanding that wanders beyond. Now, while it is true that the Vast loses sight of distinctions noticed by the petty, it does not follow that they are thereby equalized, as Guo Xiang suggests. For the Vast still embraces the petty in virtue of its very vastness. The petty, precisely in virtue of its smallness, is not able to reciprocate.

Now, the Vast that goes beyond our everyday distinctions also thereby appears to be useless. A soaring imagination may be wild and wonderful, but it is extremely impractical and often altogether useless. Indeed, Huizi, Zhuangzi’s friend and philosophical foil, chides him for this very reason. But Zhuangzi expresses disappointment in him: for his inability to sense the use of this kind of uselessness is a kind of blindness of the spirit. The useless has use, only not as seen on the ordinary level of practical affairs. It has a use in the cultivation and nurturing of the ‘shen‘ (spirit), in protecting the ancestral and preserving one’s life, so that one can last out one’s natural years and live a flourishing life. Now, this notion of a flourishing life is not to be confused with a ‘successful’ life: Zhuangzi is not impressed by worldly success. A flourishing life may indeed look quite unappealing from a traditional point of view. One may give up social ambition and retire in relative poverty to tend to one’s shen and cultivate one’s xing (nature, or life potency).

To summarize: When we wander beyond, we leave behind everything we find familiar, and explore the world in all its unfamiliarity. We drop the tools that we have been taught to use to tame the environment, and we allow it to teach us without words. We imitate its spontaneous behavior and we learn to respond immediately without fixed articulations.

b. Chapter 2: Qi Wu Lun (Discussion on Smoothing Things Out)

If the Inner Chapters form the core of the Zhuangzi collection, then the Qi Wu Lun may be thought of as forming the core of the Inner Chapters. It is, at any rate, the most complex and intricate of the chapters of the Zhuangzi, with allusions and allegories, highly condensed arguments, and baffling metaphors juxtaposed without explanation. It appears to be concerned with the deepest and most ‘abstract’ understanding of ourselves, our lives, our world, our language, and indeed of our understanding itself. The most perplexing sections concern language and judgment, and are filled with paradox, sometimes even contradiction. But the contradictions are not easy to dismiss: their context indicates that they have a deep significance. In part, they appear to attempt to express an understanding about the limits of understanding itself, about the limits of language and thought.

This creates a problem for the interpreter, and especially for the translator. How do we deal with the contradictions? The most common solution is to paraphrase them so as to remove the direct contradictoriness, under the presupposition that no sense can be made of a contradiction. The most common way to remove the contradictions is to insert references to points of view. Those translators, such as A. C. Graham, who do this are following the interpretation of the Jin dynasty commentator Guo Xiang, who presents the philosophy as a form of relativism: apparently opposing judgments can harmonized when it is recognized that they are made from different perspectives.

According to Guo Xiang’s interpretation, each thing has its own place, its own nature (ziran); and each thing has its own value that follows from its own nature. If so, then nothing should be judged by values appropriate to the natures of other things. According to Guo Xiang, the vast and the small are equal in significance: this is his interpretation of the word “qi” in the title, “equalization of all viewpoints”. Now, such a radical relativism may have the goal of issuing a fundamental challenge to the status quo, arguing that the established values have no more validity than any of the minority values, no matter how shocking they may seem to us. In this way, its effect would be one of destabilization of the social structure. Here, however, we see another of the possible consequences of such a position: its inherent conservativeness. Guo Xiang’s purpose in asserting this radical uniqueness and necessity of each position is conservative in this way. Indeed, it appears to be articulated precisely in response to those who oppose the traditional Ruist values of humanity and rightness (ren and yi) by claiming to have a superior mystical ground from which to judge them to be lacking. Guo Xiang’s aim in asserting the equality of every thing, every position, and every function, is to encourage each thing, and each person, to accept its own place in the hierarchical system, to acknowledge its value in the functioning of the whole. In this way, radical relativism actually forestalls the possibility of radical critique altogether!

According to this reading, the Vast perspective of the giant Peng bird is no better than the petty perspectives of the little birds who laugh at it. And indeed, Guo Xiang, draws precisely this conclusion. But there is a problem with taking this reading too seriously, and it is the kind of problem that plagues all forms of radical relativism when one attempts to follow them through consistently. Simply put, Zhuangzi would have to acknowledge that his own position is no better than those he appears to critique. He would have to acknowledge that his Daoist philosophy, indeed even this articulation of relativism, is no improvement over Confucianism after all, and that it is no less short-sighted than the logic-chopping of the Mohists. This, however, is a consequence that Zhuangzi does not recognize. This is surely an indication that the radical relativistic interpretation is clearly a misreading.

Recently, some western interpreters (Lisa Raphals and Paul Kjellberg, for example) have focused their attention on aspects of the text that express affinities with the Hellenistic philosophy of Skepticism. Now, it is important not to confuse this with what in modern philosophy is thought of as a doctrine of skepticism, the most common form of which is the claim that we cannot ever claim to know anything, for at least the reason that we might always be wrong about anything we claim to know—that is, because we can never know anything with absolute certainty. This is not quite the claim of the ancient Skeptics. Arguing from a position of fallibilism, these latter feel that we ought never to make any final judgments that go beyond the immediate evidence, or the immediate appearances. We should simply accept what appears at face value and have no further beliefs about its ultimate consequences, or its ultimate value. In particular, we should refrain from making judgments about whether it is good or bad for us. We bracket (epoche) these ultimate judgments. When we see that such things are beyond our ability to know with certainty, we will learn to let go of our anxieties and accept the things that happen to us with equanimity. Such a state of emotional tranquility they call ‘ataraxia.’

Now, the resonances with Zhuangzi’s philosophy are clear. Zhuangzi also accepts a form of fallibilism. While he does not refrain from making judgments, he nevertheless acknowledges that we cannot be certain that what we think of as good for us may not ultimately be bad for us, or that what we now think of as something terrible to be feared (death, for example) might not be an extraordinarily blissful awakening and a release from the toils and miseries of worldly life. When we accept this, we refrain from dividing things into the acceptable and the unacceptable; we learn to accept the changes of things in all their aspects with equanimity. In the Skeptical reading, the textual contradictions are also resolved by appealing to different perspectives from which different judgments appear to be true. Once one has learnt how to shift easily between the perspectives from which such different judgments can be made, then one can see how such apparently contradictory things can be true at the same time—and one no longer feels compelled to choose between them.

There is, however, another way to resolve these contradictions, one that involves recognizing the importance of continuous transformation between contrasting phenomena and even between opposites. In the tradition of Laozi’s cosmology, Zhuangzi’s worldview is also one of seasonal transformations of opposites. The world is seen as a giant clod (da kuai) around which the heavens (tian) revolve about a polar axis (daoshu). All transformations have such an axis, and the aim of the sage is to settle into this axis, so that one may observe the changes without being buffeted around by them.

Now, the theme of opposites is taken up by the Mohists, in their later Mohist Canon, but with a very different understanding. The later Mohists present a detailed analysis of judgments as requiring bivalence: that is judgments may be acceptable (ke) (also, ‘affirmed’ shi) or unacceptable (buke) (also ‘rejected’fei); they must be one or the other and they cannot be both. There must always be a clear distinction between the two. It is to this claim, I believe, that Zhuangzi is directly responding. Rejecting also the Mohist style of discussion, he appeals to an allusive, aphoristic, mythological style of poetic writing to upset the distinctions and blur the boundaries that the Mohists insist must be held apart. The Mohists believe that social harmony can only be achieved when we have clarity of distinctions, especially of evaluative distinctions: true/false, good/bad, beneficial/harmful. Zhuangzi’s position is that this kind of sharp and rigid thinking can result ultimately only in harming our natural tendencies (xing), which are themselves neither sharp nor rigid. If we, on the contrary, learn to nurture those aspects of our heart-minds (xin), our natural tendencies (xing), that are in tune with the natural (tian) and ancestral (zong) within us, then we will eventually find our place at the axis of the way (daoshu) and will be able to ride the transformations of the cosmos free from harm. That is, we will be able to sense and respond to what can only be vaguely expressed without forcing it into gross and unwieldy verbal expressions. We are then able to recognize the paradoxes of vagueness and indeterminacy that arise from infinitesimal processes of transformation.

Put another way, our knowledge and understanding (zhi, tong, da) are not just what we can explicitly see before us and verbalize: in modern terms, they are not just what is ‘consciously,’ ‘conceptually,’ or ‘linguistically’ available to us. Zhuangzi also insists on a level of understanding that goes beyond such relatively crude modes of dividing up our world and experiences. There are hidden modes of knowing, not evident or obviously present, modes that allow us to live, breathe, move, understand, connect with others without words, read our environments through subtle signs; these modes of knowing also give us tremendous skill in coping with others and with our environments. These modes of knowing Zhuangzi calls “wuzhi”, literally ‘without knowing,’ or ‘unknowing’. What is known by such modes of knowing, when we attempt to express it in words, becomes paradoxical and appears contradictory. It seems that bivalent distinctions leave out too much on either side of the divide: they are too crude a tool to cope with the subtlety and complexity of our non-conceptual modes of knowing. Zhuangzi, following a traditional folk psychology of his time, calls this capacity shenming: “spirit insight.”

When we nurture that deepest and most natural, most ancestral part of our pysches, through psycho-physical meditative practices, we at the same time nurture these non-cognitive modes of understanding, embodied wisdoms, that enable us to deal successfully with our circumstances. It is then that we are able to cope directly with what from the limited perspective of our ‘socialized’ and ‘linguistic’ understanding seems to be too vague, too open, too paradoxical.

c. Chapter 3: Yang Sheng Zhu (The Principle of Nurturing Life)

This chapter, like the Anarchist Utopian chapters, deals with the way to nurture and cultivate one’s ‘life tendencies’ (sheng, xing) so as to enable one to live skillfully and last out one’s natural years (zhong qi tian nian). There is a ‘potency’ within oneself that is a source of longevity, an ancestral place from which the phenomena of one’s life continue to arise. This place is to be protected (bao), kept whole (quan), nurtured and cultivated (yang). The result is a sagely and skillful life. We must be careful how we understand this word, ‘skill.’ Zhuangzi takes pains to point out that it is no mere technique. A technique is a procedure that may be mastered, but the skill of the sage goes beyond this. One might say that it has become an ‘art,’ a dao. With Zhuangzi’s conception, any physical activity, whether butchering a carcass, making wooden wheels, or carving beautiful ceremonial bell stands, becomes a dao when it is performed in a spiritual state of heightened awareness (‘attenuation’ xu).

Zhuangzi sees civic involvement as particularly inimical to the preservation and cultivation of one’s natural life. In order to cultivate one’s natural potencies, one must retreat from social life, or at least one must retreat from the highly complex and artificially structured social life of the city. One undergoes a psycho-physical training in which one’s sensory and physical capacities become honed to an extraordinary degree, indicating one’s attunement with the transformations of nature, and thus highly responsive to the tendencies (xing) of all things, people, and processes. The mastery achieved is demonstrated (both metaphorically, and literally) by practical embodied skill. That is, practical embodied skill is also a metaphor representing the mastery of the life of the sage, and so it is also a sign of sagehood (though not all those who are skillful are to be reckoned as sages). Thus, we see many examples of individuals who have achieved extraordinary levels of excellence in their achievements—practical, aesthetic, and spiritual. Butcher Ding provides an example of a practical, and very lowly skill; Liezi’s teacher, Huzi, in chapter 7, provides an example of skill in controlling the very forces responsible for life themselves. Chapter 19, Mastering Life, is replete with examples: a cicada catcher, a ferryman, a carpenter, a swimmer, and Woodcarver Qing, whose aesthetic skill reaches ‘magical’ heights.

d. Chapter 4: Ren Jian Shi (The Realm of Human Interactions)

In this chapter, Zhuangzi continues the theme broached in the last chapter, but now takes on the problem of how to maintain and preserve one’s life and last out one’s years while living in the social realm, especially in circumstances of great danger: a life of civic engagement in a time of social corruption.

The Daoists, especially the authors of the anarchistic utopian chapters, are highly critical of the artificiality required to create and sustain complex social structures. The Daoists are skeptical of the ability of deliberate planning to deal with the complexities of the world within which our social structures have their place. Even the developments of the social world when left to themselves are ‘natural’ developments, and as such escape the confines of planned, structured thinking. The more we try to control and curtail these natural meanderings, the more complicated and unwieldy the social structures become. According to the Daoists, no matter how complex we make our structures, they will never be fully able to cope with the fluid flexibility of natural changes. The Daoists perceive the unfolding of the transformations of nature as exhibiting a kind of natural intelligence, a wisdom that cannot be matched by deliberate artificial thinking, thinking that can be articulated in words. The result is that phenomena guided by such artificial structures quickly lose their course, and have to be constantly regulated, re-calibrated. This need gives rise to the development and articulation of the artificial concepts of ren and yi for the Ruists, and shi and fei for the Mohists.

The Ruists emphasize the importance of cultivating the values of ren ‘humanity’ and yi ‘appropriateness/rightness.’ The Mohists identify a bivalent structure of preference and evaluation, shifei. Our judgments can be positive or negative, and these arise out of our acceptance and rejection of things or of judgments, and these in turn arise out of our emotional responses to the phenomena of benefit and harm, that is, pleasure and pain. Thus, we set up one of two types of systems: the intuitive renyi morality of the Ruists, or the articulated structured shifei of the Mohists.

Zhuangzi sees both of these as dangerous. Neither can keep up with the complex transformations of things and so both will result in harm to our shen and xing. They lead to the desire of rulers to increase their personal profit, their pleasure, and their power, and to do so at the expense of others. The best thing is to steer clear of such situations. But there are times when one cannot do so: there is nothing one can do to avoid involvement in a social undertaking. There are also times—if one has a Ruist sensibility—when one will be moved to do what one can and must in order to improve the social situation. Zhuangzi makes up a story about Confucius’ most beloved and most virtuous follower, Yen Hui, who feels called to help ‘rectify’ the King of a state known for his selfishness and brutality.

Zhuangzi thinks that such a motivation, while admirable, is ultimately misguided. There is little to nothing one can do to change things in a corrupt world. But if you really have to try, then you should be aware of the dangers, be aware of the natures of things, and of how they transform and develop. Be on the lookout for the ‘triggers’: the critical junctures at which a situation can explode out of hand. In the presence of danger, do not confront it: always dance to one side, redirect it through skilled and subtle manipulations, that do not take control, but by adding their own weight appropriately, redirect the momentum of the situation. One must treat all dangerous social undertakings as a Daoist adept: one must perform xinzhai, fasting of the heart-mind. This is a psycho-physical discipline of attenuation, in which one nurtures one’s inner potencies by thinning out one’s personal preferences and keeping one’s emotions in check, so that one may achieve a heightened sensitivity to the tendencies of things. One then responds with the skill of a sage to the dangerous moods and intentions of one’s worldly ruler.

e. Chapter 5: De Chong Fu (Signs of the Flourishing of Potency)

This chapter is populated with a collection of characters with bodily eccentricities: criminals with amputated feet, people born with ‘ugly’ deformities, hunchbacks with no lips. Perhaps some of these are moralistic advisors, like those of chapter 4, who were unsuccessful in bringing virtue and harmony to a corrupt state, and instead received the harsh punishment of their offended ruler. But it is also possible that some were born with these physical ‘deformities.’ As the Commander of the Right says in chapter 3, “When tian (nature) gave me life, it saw to it that I would be one footed.” These then are people whose natural capacity (de) has been twisted somehow, redirected, so that it gives them a potency (de) that is beyond the normal human range. At any rate, this out of the ordinary appearance, this extraordinary physical form, is a sign of something deeper: a potency and a power (de) that connects them more closely to the ancestral source. These are the sages that Zhuangzi admires: those whose virtue (de) is beyond the ordinary, and whose signs of virtue indicate that they have gone beyond.

But what goes beyond is also the source of life. To hold fast to that which is beyond both living and dying, is perhaps also to hold fast to something more primordial that is beyond human and inhuman. To identify with and nurture this source is to nurture that which is at the root of our humanity. If so, then one does not necessarily become inhuman. Indeed, one might argue that this creates the possibility of deepening one’s most genuine humanity, insofar as this is a deeper nature still.

f. Chapter 6: Da Zong Shi (The Vast Ancestral Teacher)

The first part of this chapter is devoted to a discussion of the zhenren: the “genuine person,” or “genuine humanity,” (or in older translations, “True Man”). It begins by asking about the relation between tian and ren, the natural/heaven and the human, and suggests that the greatest wisdom lies in the ability to understand both. Thus, to be forced to choose between being natural or being human is a mistake. A genuinely flourishing human life cannot be separated from the natural, but nor can it on that account deny its own humanity. Genuine humanity is natural humanity.

There are several sections devoted to explicating this genuine humanity. We find that the genuinely human person, the zhen ren, is in tune with the cycles of nature, and is not upset by the vicissitudes of life. The zhenren like Laozi’s sage is somehow simultaneously unified with things, and yet not tied down by them. The zhenren is in tune with the cycles of nature, and with the cycles of yin yang, and is not disturbed or harmed by them. In fact, the zhenren is not harmed by them either in what appears to us to be their negative phases, nor are their most extreme phases able to upset the balance of the zhenren. This is sometimes expressed with what I take to be the hyperbole that the sage or zhenren can never be drowned by the ocean, nor burned by fire.

In the second part of the chapter, Zhuangzi hints at the process by which we are to cultivate our genuine and natural humanity. These are meditative practices and psycho-physical disciplines—”yogas” perhaps—by which we learn how to nourish the ancestral root of life that is within us. We learn how to identify with that center which functions as an axis of stability around which the cycles of emotional turbulence flow. By maintaining ourselves as a shifting and responding center of gravity we are able to maintain an equanimity without giving up our feelings altogether. We enjoy riding the dragon without being thrown around by it. Ordinarily, we are buffeted around like flotsam in a storm, and yet, by holding fast to our ancestral nature, and by following the nature of the environment—by “matching nature with nature”—we free ourselves from the mercy of random circumstances.

In this chapter we see a mature development of the ideas of life and death broached in the first three chapters. Zhuangzi continues musing on the significance of our existential predicament as being inextricably tied into interweaving cycles of darkness and light, sadness and joy, living and dying. In chapter two, it was the predicament itself that Zhuangzi described, and he tried to focus on the inseparability and indistinguishability of the two aspects of this single process of transformation. In this chapter, Zhuangzi tries to delve deeper to reach the center of balance, the ‘axis of the way,’ that allows one to undergo these changes with tranquility, and even to accept them with a kind of ‘joy.’ Not an ecstatic affirmation, to be sure, but a tranquil appreciation of the richness, beauty, and “inevitability” of whatever experiences we eventually will undergo. Again, not that we must experience whatever is ‘fated’ for us, or that we ought not to minimize harm and suffering where we can do so, but only that we should acknowledge and accept our situatedness, our thrownness into our situation, as the ‘raw materials’ that we have to deal with.

There are mystical practices hinted at that enable the sage to identify with the datong, the greater flow, not with the particular arisings of these particular emotions, or this particular body, but with what lies within (and below and above) as their ancestral root. These meditative and yogic practices are hinted at in this chapter, and also in chapter 7, but nothing in the text reveals what they are. It is not unreasonable to believe that similar techniques have been handed down by the practitioners of religious Daoism. It is clear, nonetheless, that part of the change is a change in self-understanding, self-identification. We somehow learn to expand, to wander beyond, our boundaries until they include the entire cosmic process. This entire process is seen as like a potter’s wheel, and simultaneously as a whetstone and as a grindstone, on which things are formed, and arise, sharpened, and are ground back down only to be made into new forms. With each ‘birth’ (sheng) some ‘thing’ (wu) new arises, flourishes, develops through its natural (tian) tendencies (xing), and then still following its natural tendencies, responding to those of its natural environment, it winds down: enters (ru) back into the undifferentiated (wu) from which it emerged (chu). The truest friendship arises when members of a community identify with this unknown undifferentiated process in which they are embedded, “forgotten” differences between self and other, and spontaneously follows the natural developments of which they are inseparable “parts.”

g. Chapter 7: Ying Di Wang (Responding to Emperors and Kings)

The last of the Inner Chapters does not introduce anything new, but closes by returning to a recurring theme from chapters 1, 3, 5, and 6: that of withdrawing from society. This ‘withdrawal’ has two functions: the first is to preserve one’s ‘life’; the second is to allow society to function naturally, and thus to bring itself to a harmonious completion. Rather than interfering with social interactions, one should allow them to follow their natural course, which, Zhuangzi believes, will be both imaginative and harmonious.

These themes resonate with those of the Anarchist chapters in the Outer (and Miscellaneous) chapters: 8 to 11a and 28 to 32. These encourage a life closer to nature in which one lets go of deliberate control and instead learns how to sense the tendencies of things, allowing them to manifest and flourish, while also adding one’s weight to redirect their momentum away from harm and danger. Or, if harm and danger are unavoidable, then one learns how to minimize them, and how to accept whatever one does have to suffer with equanimity.

4. Key Interpreters of Zhuangzi

The earliest of the interpreters of Zhuangzi’s philosophy are of course his followers, whose commentaries and interpretations have been preserved in the text itself, in the chapters that Liu Xiaogan ascribes to the “Shu Zhuang Pai,” chapters 17 to 27. Most of these chapters constitute holistic developments of the ideas of the Inner Chapters, but some of them concentrate on particular issues raised in particular chapters. For example, the author of Chapter 17, the Autumn Floods, elaborates on the philosophy of perspective and overcoming boundaries that is discussed in the first chapter, Xiao Yao You. This chapter develops the ideas in several divergent directions: relativism, skepticism, pragmatism, and even a kind of absolutism. Which of these, if any, is the overall philosophical perspective is not easy to discern. The author of chapter 19, Da Sheng, Mastering Life, takes up the theme of the cultivation of the wisdom of embodied skill that is introduced in chapter 3, Yang Sheng Zhu, The Principle of Nurturing Life. The author of chapter 18, Zhi Le, Utmost Happiness, and chapter 22, Zhi Bei You, Knowledge Wanders North, continues the meditations on life and death, and the cultivation of meditative practice, that are explored in chapter 6, Da Zong Shi, The Vast Ancestral Teacher.

The next group of interpreters have also become incorporated into the extant version of the text. They are the school of philosophers inclined towards anarchist utopias, that Graham identifies as a “Primitivist” and a school of “Yangists,” chapters 8 to 11, and 28 to 31. These thinkers appear to have been profoundly influenced by the Laozi, and also by the thought of the first and last of the Inner Chapters: “Wandering Beyond,” and “Responding to Emperors and Kings.” There are also possible signs of influence from Yang Zhu, whose concern was to protect and cultivate one’s inner life-source. These chapters combine the anarchistic ideals of a simple life close to nature that can be found in the Laozi with the practices that lead to the cultivation and nurturing of life. The practice of the nurturing of life in chapter 3, that leads to the “lasting out of one’s natural years,” becomes an emphasis on maintaining and protecting xing ming zhi qing “the essentials of nature and life’s command” in these later chapters.

The third main group, whose interpretation has been preserved in the text itself, is the Syncretist school, an eclectic school whose aim to is promote an ideal of mystical rulership, influenced by the major philosophical schools of the time, especially those that recommend a cultivation of inner potency. They may or may not be exemplary of the so-called ‘Huang-Lao’ school. They scoured the earlier philosophers in order to extract what was valuable in their philosophies, the element of the dao that is to be found in each philosophical claim. In particular, they sought to combine the more ‘mystically’ inclined philosophies with the more practical ones to create a more complete dao. The last chapter, Tian Xia, The World, considers several philosophical schools, and comments on what is worthwhile in each of them. Zhuangzi’s philosophy is here characterized as “vast,” “vague,” “outrageous,” “extravagant,” and “reckless”; he is also recognized for his encompassing modes of thought, his lack of partisanship, and his recklessness is acknowledged to be harmless. Nevertheless, it is stated that he did not succeed in getting it all.

Perhaps the most important of the pre-Qin thinkers to comment on Zhuangzi is Xunzi. In his “Dispelling Obsessions” chapter, anticipating the eclecticism of the Huang-Lao commentators of chapter 33, he considers several philosophical schools, mentions the corner of ‘truth’ that each has recognized, and then goes on to criticize them for failing to understand the larger picture. Xunzi mentions Zhuangzi by name, describes him as a philosopher who recognizes the value of nature and of following the tendencies of nature, but who thereby fails to recognize the value of the human ‘ren’. Indeed, Zhuangzi seems to be aware of this kind of objection, and even delights in it. He revels in knowing that he is one who wanders off into the distance, far from human concerns, one who is not bound by the guidelines. Perhaps in doing so he corroborates Xunzi’s fears.

Another text that reveals what might be a development of Zhuangzi’s philosophy is the Liezi. This is a philosophical treatise that clearly stands in the same tradition as the Zhuangzi, dealing with many of the same issues, and on occasion with almost identical stories and discussions. Although the Daoist adept, Liezi, to whom the text is attributed is said to have lived before Zhuangzi, the text clearly dates from a later period, perhaps compiled as late as the Eastern Han, though in terms of linguistic style the material appears to date from around the same period as Zhuangzi. The Liezi continues the line of philosophical thinking of the Xiao Yao You, and the Qiu Shui, taking up the themes of transcending boundaries, and even cosmic realms, by spirit journeying. The leaving behind and overturning of human values is a theme that is repeated in this text, though again not without a certain paradoxical tension: after all, the purpose of such journeying and overturning of values is ultimately to enable us in some sense to live ‘better’ lives. While Zhuangzi’s own philosophy exerted a significant influence on the interpretation of Buddhism in China, theLiezi appears to provide a possible converse case of Mahayana Buddhist influence on the development of the ideas of Zhuangzi.

The Jin dynasty scholar, Guo Xiang, is one of the most influential of the early interpreters. His “relativistic” reading of the text has become the received interpretation, and his own distinctive style of philosophical thinking has in this way become almost inseparable from that of Zhuangzi. The task of interpreting Zhuangzi independently of Guo Xiang’s reading is not easy to accomplish. His contribution and interpretation have already been discussed in the body of the entry (See sections above: The Zhuangzitext, and Chapter 2: Qi Wu Lun (Discussion on Smoothing Things Out) ). The Sui dynasty scholar, Lu Deming, produced an invaluable glossary and philological commentary on the text, enabling later generations to benefit from his vast linguistic expertise. The Ming dynasty Buddhist poet and scholar, Han Shan, wrote a commentary on the Zhuangzi from a Chan Buddhist perspective. In a similar vein, the Qing dynasty scholar, Zhang Taiyan, constructed a masterful interpretation of the Zhuangzi in the light of Chinese Buddhist Idealism, or Weishilun. Guo Qingfan, a late Qing, early twentieth century scholar, collected and synthesized the work of previous generations of commentators. The scholarly work of Takeushi Yoshio in Japan has also been of considerable influence. Qian Mu is a twentieth century scholar who has exerted considerable efforts with regard to historical scholarship. Currently, in Taiwan, Chen Guying is the leading scholar and interpreter of Zhuangzi, and he uses his knowledge of western philosophy, particularly western epistemology, cosmology, and metaphysics, to throw new light on this ancient text.

In the west, probably the most important and influential scholar was A. C. Graham, whose pioneering work on this text, and on the later Mohist Canon, has laid the groundwork and set an extraordinarily high standard for future western philosophical scholarship. Graham, following the reading of Guo Xiang, develops a relativistic reading based on a theory of the conventional nature of language. Chad Hansen is a current interpreter who sees the Daoists as largely theorists of language, and he interprets Zhuangzi’s own contribution as a form of “linguistic skepticism.” Recently, there has been a growth of interest in the aspects of Zhuangzi’s philosophy that resonate with the Hellenistic school of Skepticism. This was proposed by Paul Kjellberg, and has been pursued by other scholars such as Lisa Raphals.

5. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger, ed. Wandering at Ease in the Zhuangzi. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1998.
Ames, Roger, and Takahiro Nakajima. Zhuangzi and the Happy Fish. Honolulu: University of Hawai`i Press, 2015.
Chai, David. Early Zhuangzi Commentaries: On the Sounds and Meanings of the Inner Chapters. Sarrbrucken: VDM Publishing, 2008.
Chuang Tzu. Basic Writings. Translated by Burton Watson. New York: Columbia University Press, 1964.
Chuang Tzu. The Complete Works of Chuang Tzu. Translated by Burton Watson. New York: Columbia University Press, 1968.
Chuang Tzu. Chuang-Tzu The Inner Chapters: A Classic of Tao. Translated by A. C. Graham. London: Mandala, 1991.
Chuang Tzu. Chuang tzu. Translated by James Legge, Sacred Books of the East, volumes 39, 40. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1891.
Cook, Scott. Hiding the World Within the World: Ten Uneven Discourses on Zhuangzi. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.
Coutinho, Steve. An Introduction to Daoist Philosophies. New York: Columbia University Press, 2014.
Coutinho, Steve. “Conceptual Analyses of the Zhuangzi”. Dao Companion to Daoist Philosophy. Springer, 2014.
Coutinho, Steve. “Zhuangzi”. Berkshire Dictionary of Chinese Biography, pp. 149-162. 2014.
Coutinho, Steve. Zhuangzi and Early Chinese Philosophy: Vagueness, Transformation, and Paradox. London: Ashgate Press, forthcoming, December, 2004.
Fung, Yu-Lan. Chuang-Tzu: A New Selected Translation with an Exposition of the Philosophy of Kuo Hsiang. 2nd ed. New York: Paragon Book Reprint Corporation, 1964.
Graham, Angus Charles. Later Mohist Logic, Ethics and Science. London: School of Oriental and African Studies, 1978.
Graham, Angus Charles. Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China. La Salle: Open Court, 1989.
Graham, A. C. “Chuang-tzu’s Essay on Seeing things as Equal.” History of Religions 9 (1969/1970), pp. 137—159. Reproduced in Roth, 2003.
Graham, A. C. “Chuang-tzu: Textual Notes to a Partial Translation.” London: School of Oriental and African Studies, 1982. Reproduced in Roth, 2003.
Hansen, Chad. A Daoist Theory of Chinese Thought: A Philosophical Interpretation. New York, Oxford University Press, 1992.
Ivanhoe, P. J. & Paul Kjellberg, ed. Essays on Skepticism, Relativism, and Ethics in the Zhuangzi. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1996.
Kaltenmark, Max. Lao Tzu and Taoism. Translated by Roger Greaves. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1969.
Kjellberg, Paul. Zhuangzi and Skepticism. PhD dissertation, Department of Philosophy, Stanford University, 1993.
Klein, Esther. (2010). Were there “Inner Chapters” in the Warring States? A new examination of evidence about the Zhuangzi. T’oung Pao, 4/5, pp. 299–369.
Kohn, Livia. Zhuangzi: Text and Context. Three Pines Press, 2014.
Kohn, Livia. New Visions of the Zhuangzi. Three Pines Press, 2015.
Lawton, Thomas, ed. New Perspectives on Chu Culture During the Eastern Zhou Period. Washington, D.C.: Smithsonian Institution, 1991.
Li, Xueqin. Eastern Zhou and Qin Civilizations. Translated by Kwang-chih Chang. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1985.
Liu, Xiaogan. Classifying the Zhuangzi Chapters. Translated by Donald Munro. Michigan Monographs in Chinese Studies, no. 65. Ann Arbor, Michigan: The University of Michigan, 1994.
Mair, Victor H., ed. Experimental Essays on Chuang-tzu. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1983.
Mair, Victor. ed. Chuang-tzu: Composition and Interpretation. Symposium issues, Journal of Chinese Religions 11, 1983.
Mair, Victor. Wandering on the Way: Early Taoist Tales and Parables of Chuang Tzu. New York: Bantam Books, 1994.
Maspero, Henri. Le Taoïsme. Vol. II, Mélanges Posthumes sur les Religions et l’histoire de la Chine. Paris: Civilisations du Sud S.A.E.P., 1950.
McCraw, David. Stratifying Zhuangzi: Rhyme and other quantitative evidence. Language and Linguistics Monograph Series, 41. Taipei, Taiwan: Institute of Linguistics, Academia Sinica, 2010.
Roth, Harold. “Who Compiled the Chuang-tzu?” in Chinese Texts and Philosophical Contexts. edited by Henry Rosemont. La Salle: Open Court, 1991.
Roth, Harold. A Companion to A. C. Graham’s Chuang Tzu: The Inner Chapters. Honolulu: University of Hawai’i Press, 2003.
Wang, Bo. Thinking Through the Inner Chapters. Three Pines Press, 2014.
Wu, Kuang-ming. The Butterfly as Companion: Meditations on the First Three Chapters of the Chuang Tzu. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1990.
Ziporyn, Brook. Zhuangzi: The Essential Writings: With Selections from Traditional Comentaries. Hackett, 2009.

Author Information

Steve Coutinho
Email: coutinho@muhlenberg.edu
Muhlenberg College
U. S. A.

Zhang Zai (Chang Tsai, 1020—1077)

Chang_Tsai Zhang Zai was one of the pioneers of the Song dynasty philosophical movement called “Study of the Way,” often known as Neo-Confucianism. One of the most distinctive features of many of these new ways of thought being formulated at the time was an increased interest in metaphysics, usually influenced by the Classic of Changes (Yijing). Zhang’s most significant contributions to Chinese philosophy were primarily in the area of metaphysics, where he came up with a new theory of qi that was very influential. He is also credited with differentiating original nature and physical nature, which was to become a key concept in the most prominent Song philosophers, the Cheng brothers and Zhu Xi (Chu Hsi). Ethically, his most influential doctrines were found in the brief essay “Western Inscription,” where he propounded the ideas of being one body with all things and universal caring. After his death, most of his disciples were absorbed into the Cheng brothers’ school and his thought become known primarily through the efforts of the Cheng brothers and Zhu Xi, who honored Zhang as one of the founders of the Study of the Way.

Life and Work
Metaphysics
Human Nature and Ethics
Moral Education and the Heart
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Zhang Zai is also known as Zhang Hengqu, after the town where he grew up and later did much of his teaching. He was born in 1020 and died in 1077. As a youth he was interested in military affairs, but began studying the Confucian texts on the recommendation of an important official who was impressed with Zhang’s abilities. Like most of the Song philosophers, Zhang was initially dissatisfied with Confucian thought and studied Buddhism and Daoism for several years. Eventually, however, he decided that the Way was not to be found in Buddhism or Daoism and returned to Confucian texts. This acquaintance with the other major ways of thought was to have significant influence on Zhang’s own views. According to tradition, around 1056 Zhang sat on a tiger skin in the capital and lectured on the Classic of Changes. It may have been during this period that he first became acquainted with the Cheng brothers, who were actually his younger cousins. After passing the highest level of the civil service examinations, he held a series of minor government posts.

In 1069 Zhang was recommended to the emperor and given a position in the capital, but not long after he ran into conflict with the prime minister and retired home to Hengqu, where he spent his time in retirement studying and teaching. This was probably his most productive period for developing and spreading his own philosophy. In 1076 he completed his most important work, Correcting Ignorance, and presented it to his disciples. “Western Inscription” was originally part of this longer work. That same year he was summoned back to the capital and restored to an important position. However, in the winter he became ill and resigned again to try to convalesce at home. He never reached home, dying on the road in 1077. Zhang was awarded a posthumous title in 1220 and enshrined in the Confucian temple in 1241. Many of Zhang’s writings have been lost. Zhu Xi collected selections of Zhang’s writings in his anthology of Song Study of the Way known as Reflections on Things at Hand. His most important surviving works are probably his commentary on the Changes and Correcting Ignorance.

2. Metaphysics

Zhang Zai’s metaphysics is largely based on the Classic of Changes, especially one of the commentaries, “Appended Remarks,” traditionally attributed to Confucius. According to Zhang, all things of the world are composed of a primordial substance called qi. Qi is sometimes translated as “substance,” “matter,” or “material force, but there is really no term in English that can capture its meaning for Zhang. Qi originally meant “breath” and is a very old concept in Chinese culture, particularly medicine. For Zhang, qi includes matter and the forces that govern interactions between matter, yin and yang. In its dispersed, rarefied state, qi is invisible and insubstantial, but when it condenses it becomes a solid or liquid and takes on new properties. All material things are composed of condensed qi: rocks, trees, even people. There is nothing that is not qi. Thus, in a real sense, everything has the same essence, an idea which has important ethical implications.

Zhang believed that qi is never created or destroyed; the same qi goes through a continuous process of condensation and dispersion. He compared it to water: water in liquid form or frozen into ice is still the same water. Similarly, condensed qi which forms things or dispersed qi is still the same substance. Condensation is theyin force of qi and dispersion is the yang force. In its wholly dispersed state, Zhang refers to qi as the Great Vacuity, a term he adopted from the Zhuangzi. He emphasized that though this qi is insubstantial, it still exists, and thus is very different from the Buddhist concept of emptiness. Whereas Buddhists argued that the fact that everything changes shows it has no essence and is unreal, Zhang argued that the very fact that it changes proves it is real. Everything that is real is composed of qi, and since qi always changes, anything real must change. Although the Great Vacuity always exists, the particular qi that is dispersed into the Great Vacuity at any time is not the same, which allows Zhang to assert both that qi always changes and the Great Vacuity always remains. There is no such thing as creation ex nihilo for Zhang, an idea he attributes to both Buddhists and Daoists.

Qi begins dispersed and undifferentiated in the Great Vacuity and through condensation forms material things. When these material things pass away, their qi disperses and rejoins the Great Vacuity to begin the process again. What looks like creation and destruction is just the never-ending movements of qi. These processes of condensation and dispersion have no outside cause; they are just part of the nature of qi. Zhang wholly naturalized the workings of qi and rejected any idea of an anthropomorphic Heaven that controlled things. While the Classic of Changes talked of the workings of ghosts and spirits, he reinterpreted these terms to mean the extending and receding of qi from and back to the Great Vacuity. It is all a naturally occurring process.

Unlike later thinkers like the Cheng brothers and Zhu Xi, the concept of pattern (li, also translated as “principle”) is not that important in Zhang’s philosophy. While in the thought of Cheng Yi and Zhu Xi, pattern is a transcendental universal that exists outside of qi, Zhang denied there was anything outside of qi. He seems to use pattern to describe the actions of qi condensing and dispersing, and for the pattern actions should fit to be moral. It certainly has none of the importance for Zhang that it did for some of his successors. Zhu Xi criticized Zhang for this, saying that qi was not enough to explain the workings of the universe without pattern as well.

3. Human Nature and Ethics

Mencius‘s belief that human nature is good, and his theory of qi allowed him to come up with what became the definitive Song answer to a classic problem in Mencius’ thought: if human nature is good, what makes people bad? Zhang’s solution involved positing two ways of looking at nature: the original nature and nature embodied in qi. Zhang claimed original nature exists forever in unchanging perfection, as opposed to material things which decay and die. This raises the question of what original nature consists of, since Zhang has claimed that everything is qi and qi always changes. He is not very clear on this point, but he apparently identified original nature with the undifferentiated qi of the Great Vacuity. When qi condenses to form human beings, each somehow retains some of the character of the unity of the Great Vacuity (or Great Harmony, as he sometimes calls it). This is the original nature, and that is what is good.

However, human beings also have a nature embodied in qi, which Zhang calls physical nature. Being ordinary qi, physical nature changes, eventually dissipating upon death. Zhang theorized that the physical nature obscures the original nature, preventing it from being fulfilled, and this is what causes people to stray from the path of goodness. At one point, he stated that if clear yang qi formed the greater part of physical nature one’s moral capacities would function, but if turbid yin qi dominated, material desires would hold sway. However, it is unclear whether he meant all yang qi was clear and all yin qi was turbid, and he often seems to attach no particular moral weight to whether qi is primarily yang (dispersed) or yin (condensed). As we are all different individuals, we all have slightly different physical natures. Some people are naturally bigger and stronger, some are more generous, some are wiser. This is all a result of the particular endowment of qi that makes up the individual, and since qi condenses into things without cause or direction, there is no reason an individual has the particular physical nature he starts out with: it is just a matter of chance. What is important in terms of moral cultivation is there is also the potential to transform one’s physical nature and fulfill one’s original nature.

Zhang had a deep faith in the potential for human improvement. Like earlier Confucian thinkers such as Mencius and Xunzi, he believed that moral development was a matter of effort, not ability. In a departure from his metaphysical views, where he held that qi changes naturally with no particular rhyme or reason, he claimed that the human heart has the capacity to alter one’s own qi. One can change one’s physical nature in order to fulfill one’s original nature. If that were not possible, goodness would be a matter of chance, being born with the right kind of qi. Zhang said that only the qi of life span, which determines whether one dies young or lives to an old age, cannot be changed. This was Zhang’s attack on longevity-oriented Daoists, who taught techniques that promised to increase one’s life span or even confer immortality. Undoubtedly, part of the goal of Zhang’s theory of qi and physical nature was to refute Buddhist and Daoist teachings.Many Song and Ming thinkers, such as Zhu Xi and Wang Yangming, identified desires as one of the main obstacles to moral development. Zhang Zai was no exception to this trend, which was also probably due to Buddhist influence. The issue of how to moderate or channel desires had been discussed in Chinese philosophy at least since Mencius and Xunzi, but while the earlier Confucian tradition had emphasized finding the proper outlet to express desires and not letting them entirely control one’s actions, eliminating desires entirely never seemed to be a real option. In Xunzi’s case, at least, he clearly denied it was possible to get rid of desires. Eliminating desires was a main focus of Buddhism, on the other hand, and this view of desires was adopted by many of these Study of the Way philosophers. These thinkers focused mainly on what we might call sensual desires. The desire to be a good person was naturally not a cause for concern, but desires for fine clothes, good food, and sex were seen as interfering with one’s original nature. Zhang used the term “material desires,” identifying them with physical nature, so they had to be overcome to return to one’s original nature. Desires somehow arise from the interaction of yin and yang that produces material objects, though Zhang is none too clear exactly what this process is. The fundamental point is that following one’s desires is giving into physical nature and regressing farther and farther away from original goodness.

Overcoming the desires of physical nature, one progresses toward original nature, or the heavenly within, as Zhang also put it. In “Western Inscription” Zhang illustrated this ideal state. Putting aside selfishness, one comes to understand the essential unity of all things. All things are formed from the same qi, and ultimately we all share the same substance. This was to become Zhang’s most famous ethical doctrine, the idea of forming one body with all things. As Zhang wrote in “Western Inscription, “That which fills the universe I regard as my body.” Everyone has Heaven and Earth as their father and mother, and thus everyone are brothers and sisters. Caring for others is like caring for one’s own family. Zhang further wrote, “Even those who are tired, infirm, crippled, or sick; those who have no brothers or children, wives, or husbands, are all my brothers who are in distress and have no one to turn to.” Though there are some precedents for this idea of brotherhood in earlier Confucianism, it sounds much more like the great compassion of Buddhism or the Mohist idea of universal caring—Zhang even uses the same term (jian’ai). In response to a question about this apparent slide into Mohism, Cheng Yi admitted that “Western Inscription” went a little too far, but still defended it as going beyond what previous sages had discussed and being as meritorious as Mencius’ idea of the goodness of human nature. Later thinkers recognized “Western Inscription” as Zhang’s greatest contribution to the Study of the Way.

4. Moral Education and the Heart

Presaging Zhu Xi, Zhang emphasized the role of education in moral development. Education was the way one transformed one’s qi and overcame physical nature. Following earlier philosophers such as Confucius and Xunzi, Zhang insisted that learning should always be directed toward moral cultivation, which in his case meant returning to one’s original nature. Knowledge was not important for its own sake, but for its contributions to moral character. Despite this, Zhang’s own interests were fairly wide-ranging, and he was especially interested in observing and explaining natural phenomena such as the movements of the stars and planets. Nevertheless, he tended not to emphasize this kind of scientific study in his writings on education, which focused on ritual and the classical Confucian texts. Compared with his contemporaries, Zhang placed more importance on the study of ritual. He believed ritual derived from original nature, and following it helps one hold onto original nature and overcome the obstructions of physical nature. Zhang’s interest in the Classic of Changes has already been mentioned, and he also recommended studying the other Confucian classics, the Analects, and Mencius. In contrast to some later Study of the Way philosophers, he did not put a lot of weight on histories, considering them inferior to the classics for helping people transform their qi.

Though Zhang recommended reciting and memorizing these books, he still believed that books were a means to returning to one’s original nature, not an end in themselves. Books functioned like a set of directions: they could tell you how to get to the destination, but they should be not confused with the destination. He felt close reading and textual criticism was not necessary, and getting too caught up in the meaning of a word or sentence could detract from understanding the overall meaning. And even in the classics, not everything should be accepted. Zhang recalled Mencius’ criticism of literal readings of the Classic of Documents and pointed out the necessity for understanding the classics in light of one’s own sense of what is right. This seems to set up a paradox: a student needs to study the classics to return to his original nature and know what is right, but he needs to know what is right to properly understand the classics.

Zhang resolved this contradiction by positing an innate moral sense in everyone that he called “this heart,” a term he apparently adopted from the Mencius. “This heart” presumably belongs to the original nature, and is still present even when embodied in qi, but it can be obstructed and blocked by the physical nature. Zhang referred to this situation as the problem of the “fixed heart” blocking “this heart.” The fixed heart means having intentions, certainty, inflexibility, and egotism. Under these conditions, “this heart” will not function properly and one will have difficulty understanding the classics. The learner must get rid of the fixed heart to let “this heart” free. At times, Zhang suggests that reading books itself helps preserve “this heart,” and it is this heart itself that understands the Way. Ritual is perhaps more important than books. Zhang once suggested that even the illiterate could still develop “this heart,” but apparently ritual was indispensable in overcoming the fixed heart.

Zhang also talked of “expanding the heart” and “making the heart vast.” Both these phrases mean eliminating the obstructions of the fixed heart and putting the heart in a state where it is ready to understand. He tended to value knowledge apprehended directly through the heart over knowledge from sense perception. Zhang did not deny the validity of empirical knowledge, but he believed its scope was limited. Knowledge gained from sense perception is just knowledge of things, not knowledge of the Way. Knowledge of the Way is knowledge gained through the virtuous nature, not through sense perception. “Knowledge gained through the virtuous nature” is another way of saying knowledge apprehended directly by the heart, though Zhang seems to be talking more about a kind of mystic experience than rationalism: he wrote that understanding of the Way is not something thought and consideration can bring about.

The goal of moral cultivation was fulfilling one’s original nature. This was Zhang Zai’s definition of becoming a sage, the term in Chinese philosophy for a perfected person. Another term common in philosophical discourse of the time was integrity or authenticity (cheng). Integrity figured in some important passages in the Doctrine of the Mean, which was one of the most important Confucian texts in Song Study of the Way. Zhang emphasized “integrity resulting from clarity,” which he explained as first coming to understanding through study and inquiry and then fulfilling one’s nature. This could be a long and difficult process, but if one could persist and make the necessary effort, one could fulfill one’s nature and become a sage. There was no greater goal for Zhang.

5. References and Further Reading

Very little is available in English on Zhang Zai. The reader is encouraged to look into general histories of Chinese philosophy, especially those dealing with neo-Confucianism, in addition to the works listed here.

Chan, Wing-tsit. A Sourcebook in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
- Translates a selection of Zhang’s works, focusing on Correcting Ignorance.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. Reflections on Things at Hand: The Neo-Confucian Anthology Compiled by Chu Hsi and Lü Tsu-chien. New York: Columbia University Press, 1967.
- This probably contains the most extensive collection of Zhang’s writings in English. Chan includes a finding list to help the reader find the selections of a particular philosopher.
Chow, Kai-wing. “Ritual, Cosmology, and Ontology: Chang Tsai’s Moral Philosopy.” Philosophy East and West 43.2 (April 1993): 201-28.
- Emphasizes the importance of ritual in moral development.
Huang, Siu-chi. “Chang Tsai’s Concept of Ch’i.” Philosophy East and West 18.4 (October 1968): 247-60.
Huang, Siu-chi. “The Moral Point of View of Chang Tsai.” Philosophy East and West 21.2 (April 1971): 141-56.
Kasoff, Ira. The Thought of Chang Tsai. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984.
- This is the only English-language monograph on Zhang’s philosophy.
T’ang, Chün-i. “Chang Tsai’s Theory of Mind and Its Metaphysical Basis.” Philosophy East and West 6.2 (July 1956): 113-36.

Author Information

David Elstein
Email: davidelstein@world.oberlin.edu
State University of New York at New Paltz
U. S. A.

Foreknowledge and Free Will

Suppose it were known, by someone else, what you are going to choose to do tomorrow. Wouldn’t that entail that tomorrow you must do what it was known in advance that you would do? In spite of your deliberating and planning, in the end, all is futile: you must choose exactly as it was earlier known that you would. The supposed exercise of your free will is ultimately an illusion.

Historically, the tension between foreknowledge and the exercise of free will was addressed in a religious context. According to orthodox views in the West, God was claimed to be omniscient (and hence in possession of perfect foreknowledge) and yet God was supposed to have given humankind free will. Attempts to solve the apparent contradiction often involved attributing to God special properties, for example, being “outside” of time.

However, the trouble with such solutions is that they are generally unsatisfactory on their own terms. Even more serious is the fact that they leave untouched the problem posed not by God’s foreknowledge but that of any human being. Do human beings have foreknowledge? Certainly, of at least some events and behaviors. Thus we have a secular counterpart of the original problem. A human being’s foreknowledge, exactly as would God’s, of another’s choices would seem to preclude the exercise of human free will.

In this article, various ways of trying to solve the problem—for example, by putting constraints on the truth-conditions for statements, or by “tightening” the conditions necessary for knowledge—are examined and shown not to work. Ultimately the alleged incompatibility of foreknowledge and free will is shown to rest on a subtle logical error. When the error, a modal fallacy, is recognized and remedied, the problem evaporates.

Introduction: The Problem of Foreknowledge and Free Will
Three Kinds of Determinism
The Relationship Between Epistemic and Logical Determinism
Attacking the Premises of Deterministic Arguments
1. Can a Future Contingent be true prior to the event it refers to?
2. Can a Future Contingent be known prior to the event it refers to?
Possibility, Necessity, and Contingency
The Modal Fallacy
1. The Modal Fallacy in Logical Determinism
2. The Modal Fallacy in Epistemic Determinism
Residual concerns – Changing the past; Changing the future
Concluding Remarks
References and Further Reading
Notes

1. Introduction: The Problem of Foreknowledge and Free Will

Moses Maimonides (1135-1204) has set out the problem in the traditional manner:

…”Does God know or does He not know that a certain individual will be good or bad? If thou sayest ‘He knows’, then it necessarily follows that [that] man is compelled to act as God knew beforehand he would act, otherwise God’s knowledge would be imperfect.…” (1966, pp. 99-100)

The argument can be extended. The thrust of the argument does not apply only to doing good or ill, but indeed to every human act, from the most mundane to the most significant. The argument could just as well read:

“Does God know or does He not know that a certain individual (let’s say the Prime Minister of Canada), on Feb. 3, 2081, will put on brown shoes when dressing in the morning? If thou sayest ‘He knows’, then it necessarily follows that the Prime Minister is compelled to act (that is, to put on brown shoes) as God knew beforehand he/she would, otherwise God’s knowledge would be imperfect. …”

The argument for the seeming impossibility of both God’s having foreknowledge and our having free will has troubled religious thinkers, philosophers, and jurists for centuries.

It is clear why theologians are troubled by the challenge of foreknowledge and free will. For most religions insist that God has given human beings free will and thus human beings can choose right from wrong, and that (in some religions at least) wrongful acts are sinful and worthy of divine punishment, while good acts are righteous and worthy of divine reward. But many of these same religions will also insist that God is omniscient, that is, God knows everything (and thus has perfect foreknowledge).^[1] To deny either of these claims – that human beings have free will or that God is omniscient – amounts to heresy. Yet, on the face of it, each of these two claims appears to contradict the other.

But why should secular philosophers and jurists also be concerned with this conundrum? For two reasons.

First is that many, perhaps most, contemporary philosophers and jurists are keen to preserve the viability of the concept of free will. Our legal institutions, our very sense of what is praiseworthy and what is blameworthy, turn on the notion of free will. It is at the conceptual bedrock of our civilization that persons are creatures having the capacity of deliberation, that we have the ability to recognize right from wrong, that we have the ability to choose (to a large extent) what we do (and what we do not do), and – most especially – we are responsible for what we choose to do (and responsible for what we choose not to do).

Second is that the challenge to the existence of free will is posed not just by God’s foreknowledge but by any foreknowledge whatsoever. The religious version of the puzzle arises because God is said to have omniscience, that is, knowledge of everything. But the problem would arise if anyone at all (that is, anyone whatsoever) were to have knowledge of our future actions. This generalized version of the problem has come to be known as the problem of Epistemic Determinism (“epistemic” because it involves knowledge; see Epistemology). For example, if my wife were to know today that I would choose tea (rather than coffee) for my breakfast tomorrow, then one could argue (paralleling Maimonides’s argument) that it would be impossible for me not to choose tea tomorrow at breakfast.

The two concepts – (i) foreknowledge and (ii) human freedom – seem to be utterly incompatible. The challenge, then, (that is, the problem posed by epistemic determinism) is to find a way to show that

either	(1)	foreknowledge (of human beings’ future actions) does not exist;
or	(2)	free will does not exist;
or	(3)	the alleged logical relation between foreknowledge and the exercise of free will is mistaken (that is, foreknowledge is not incompatible with the exercise of free will).

Historically, some theologians have tried to solve the puzzle by invoking unique properties of God. For example, some have argued that God is ‘outside of time’ (or that ‘His knowledge is timeless’) and thus His knowledge is not foreknowledge at all, that is, God’s knowledge does not occur before (or during, or after, for that matter) any events in the world. The trouble with such solutions is (a) they leave non-theistic versions of the puzzle untouched (for example, my wife’s knowing that I will drink tea tomorrow), and (b) we can construct a revised version of the puzzle explicitly invoking God’s timelessness, for example:

God is omniscient and His knowledge is timeless—that is, God knows timelessly all that has happened, is happening, and will happen. Therefore, if He knows timelessly that a person will perform such-and-such an action, then it is impossible for that person not to perform that action.

Some other theologians have argued that God has a ‘special way’ of knowing. Unlike human beings (and other sentient creatures) who must causally interact with the world (for example, read a report, see an event, examine evidence [such as ashes, skid marks, etc.]), God is said to “know directly“—that is, without the need of sensory data or of physical interaction with the world. Such a notion of ‘direct knowledge’ is problematic in itself; but more importantly, it is hard to see how it solves the problem at hand, indeed how it even addresses the problem. For, again, as was the case with arguing that God’s knowledge is outside of time, the same two objections can be raised to this putative solution: (a’) this latter attempted solution leaves the non-theistic version of the puzzle untouched; and (b’) we can construct a revised version of the puzzle explicitly invoking God’s “direct knowledge,” for example:

God knows directly (that is, without sensory data) all that has happened, is happening, and will happen. Therefore, if He knows directly that a person will perform such-and-such an action, then it is impossible for that person not to perform that action.

Contemporary philosophers, especially secular ones, seek a solution elsewhere. We are disinclined to pursue solutions that call upon special properties of God, especially since any such solution leaves the ‘secular’ version of the problem untouched.

The focus of attention has shifted dramatically. Secular philosophers argue that the supposed incompatibility arises out of a very subtle but seductive logical fallacy. So unobvious is this fallacy that it escaped detection by Maimonides and hundreds (perhaps even countless thousands) of other persons. The error has come to bear the name “The Modal Fallacy.”

However, before we examine the Modal Fallacy, we need to delve deeper into the notions of determinism, truth, and knowledge.

2. Three Kinds of Determinism

There are three distinct versions of determinism: logical, epistemic, and causal. Each has been alleged to pose a threat to the exercise of free will, indeed it has been claimed of each version that its existence is incompatible with the existence of free will.

1. Logical determinism is most frequently couched as the problem of “future contingents.” The threat to the exercise of free will arises from the thesis that the truth-value (that is, the truth or falsity) of any proposition is timeless (that is, those propositions that are true are always true, and those propositions that are false are always false). (Note that the term “proposition” is being used strictly, as is common in philosophy, to refer roughly to the meanings of (indicative or declarative) sentences; see sec. 2 of Truth.) Thus:

If a proposition about some future action you undertake (let’s say tomorrow) is true, then it is true now. But if it is true now, then tomorrow you must undertake that action, that action must occur, you are powerless to prevent yourself from undertaking that action.

(Note that “logical” in the phrase “logical determinism” is not meant to contrast with “illogical”, but instead refers to a particular concept of logic, namely truth itself.)

2. Epistemic determinism has a strikingly similar formulation. Instead of simply attributing truth (or falsity) to propositions about the future, epistemic determinism concerns such propositions’ being known prior to the times of the occurrences they refer to. We then get this argument, parallel to the preceding one:

If a proposition about some future action you undertake is known (in advance), then (when the time comes) you must undertake that action, that action must occur, you are powerless to prevent yourself from undertaking that action.

3. Causal determinism is the thesis that all events (occurrences, processes, etc.) are the result of Laws of Nature and of antecedent conditions and of nothing else. Thus (to cite an example made famous by Carl Hempel), when a car radiator cracks overnight, it is the consequence of laws pertaining to the tensile strength of iron, of laws pertaining to the expansion of water upon freezing, to the structure of the radiator, to its being filled with water without anti-freeze, and to the temperature’s falling well below freezing for several hours (Hempel, 1942). In the case of human beings’ acting, the same scenario is said to obtain.

If whatever one does is the result of Laws of Nature and of one’s physical and genetic makeup and one’s personal history, then – since all these ‘factors’ are ‘set’ (or ‘in place’) at the moment of one’s acting – you must undertake the action you perform, that action must occur, you are powerless to prevent yourself from undertaking that action.

Three arguments all with the same conclusion, namely that your actions are ‘determined’ (in one of three different ways) and thus your actions are “unfree.” Free will is an illusion.

Of the three deterministic arguments, the most difficult to engage is the third, that of causal determinism. Indeed, so knotted is that argument, and so contentious are the issues surrounding its presuppositions, it is treated separately in this Encyclopedia. (See, for example, “Laws of Nature.”)

Note: From this point on, this article will examine only Epistemic Determinism and Logical Determinism.

3. The Relationship Between Epistemic and Logical Determinism

Since the ground-breaking work of Plato (427?-347? B.C.E.) most philosophers have agreed that there are (at least) three conditions that must be satisfied for a human being, let’s say “x”, to have knowledge of matters of fact, let’s say “P”:

P (is true)
x has good evidence, e, that P (and has little, or no, countervailing evidence)^[2]
x believes, on the basis of e, that P

In the case of God, one may want to drop the second condition, the evidential requirement, allowing that God knows directly without the need of evidence. The third condition, the belief-condition, poses certain problems as well. In the case of human beings, this condition captures the ‘mental’ or ‘cognitive’ aspect of knowledge. But the beliefs of an omniscient God are unlike those of human beings. The beliefs of human beings are finite, shifting, fallible, and corrigible. Those of an omniscient God are infinite, unchanging, infallible, and incorrigible. Perhaps, then, “believes” is not quite the right word to use when speaking of God’s knowledge, but no other is ready at hand.

Be this as it may, there remains one common element (at least) in the case of a human being’s having knowledge and God’s having knowledge, namely what is known is true. Neither God nor any human being can literally know anything that is in fact false. Put another way, truth is a prerequisite of knowledge (or using the vocabulary of logic, truth is a necessary condition for knowledge). (In the case of God, truth is not only a necessary condition for His knowledge, it is also sufficient. If we let “g” stand for “God”, “K” for “knows”, then gKP implies P, and P implies gKP.) Someone may believe strongly that some proposition is true, indeed he may insist that he knows, he may insist that he has incontrovertible evidence that that proposition is true, but if that proposition is in fact false, then he does not know. (This is not to say that he must have some way of finding out that he is mistaken. We are here divorcing truth from belief.) Every proposition that is genuinely known (that is, to be true) is true; but the converse – namely that every proposition that is true is known – certainly does not hold for less-than-omniscient human beings.

The upshot is that the premises of the argument for Epistemic Determinism (that is, that there can be knowledge of some [at least] of a person’s future actions) presuppose the premises of the argument for Logical Determinism. For, simply, if there is knowledge now (that is, prior to the occurrence) of some future actions, then there are propositions about the future that are true now. If one were able to reject the premises of the argument for Logical Determinism, one would thereby render the argument for Epistemic Determinism unsound.

4. Attacking the Premises of Deterministic Arguments

As is the case with any argument, four responses are possible.

One can accept the argument. In effect, this is to say that one regards the argument as being sound, that is, as having true premises and as being valid.
One can argue that although the argument is valid, its premise-set is false (and thus its conclusion is unsupported).
One can reject the validity of the argument, in particular by arguing that although the premise-set is true, the conclusion does not follow from that premise-set.
Finally, one can adopt both of the immediately preceding two strategies, that is, argue that not only is the premise-set false, the argument is invalid to boot.

Some religious groups (for example, the early Calvinists) have adopted the first option. They accept the soundness of the deterministic arguments and – giving primacy to God’s knowledge over human beings’ free will – argue that free will does not exist.

Needless to say, very few others have been inclined to adopt such a view, indeed most persons who are familiar with the deterministic arguments are strongly motivated to rebut such a view. Such persons will, therefore, examine the possibility of adopting option 2 or 3. We turn, then, first, to see whether one can cogently rebut the premises of the argument for Logical Determinism.

a. Can a Future Contingent be true prior to the event it refers to?

Propositions about future events, or, if one prefers, about future matters of fact, are known as future contingents. The earliest discussion of future contingents, and the attendant problem of logical determinism, occurs in Aristotle‘s De Interpretatione 9 (1963, Chapter 9, pp. 50-53). There, Aristotle discusses the case of “Tomorrow’s Sea Battle.” His argument, reconstructed and embellished, is this:

Two warring admirals, A and B, are preparing their fleets for a decisive sea battle tomorrow. The battle will be fought until one side is victorious. But the “logical laws (or principles)” of the excluded middle (every proposition is either true or false) and of noncontradiction (no proposition is both true and false), require that one of the propositions, “A wins” and “it is false that A wins,” is true and the other is false. Suppose “A wins” is (today) true. Then whatever A does (or fails to do) today will make no difference: A must win; similarly, whatever B does (or fails to do) today will make no difference: the outcome is already settled (that is, A must win). Or again, suppose “A wins” is (today) false. Then no matter what A does today (or fails to do), it will make no difference: A must lose; similarly, no matter what B does (or fails to do), it will make no difference: the outcome is already settled (that is, A must lose). Thus, if every proposition is either true or false (and not both), then planning, or as Aristotle put it ‘taking trouble’, is futile. The future will be what it will be, irrespective of our planning, intentions, etc.

How might one try to rebut the premises of Aristotle’s argument?

Proposal One: One might argue that propositions are not true in advance of the events described. Propositions ‘become’ true when the events described occur.

First objection to Proposal One: (i) Sirhan Sirhan killed Robert F. Kennedy. But when did it ‘become true’ that Sirhan Sirhan killed Kennedy? At the moment of his pulling the trigger? But the bullet was not yet lodged in Kennedy’s body. At the time of the bullet’s entering Kennedy’s body? But Kennedy did not die immediately. He was rushed to a hospital where he died some hours later. At the moment of Kennedy’s death? But at that moment Sirhan Sirhan was in the custody of police in a building remote from the hospital where Kennedy was. (This conundrum is the handiwork of Judith Jarvis Thomson (1971).) The point is that although it is clearly true that Sirhan Sirhan killed Kennedy, it is problematic to pin down an exact time (or even a candidate for the exact time) when Sirhan killed Kennedy and, by extension, when it ‘became true’ that Sirhan killed Kennedy. (ii) When did Germany lose World War II? When the Allies’ invasion force landed on the beaches of Normandy? When British scientists and engineers invented and were able to use radar against the German Luftwaffe? When Alan Turing and his team broke the German secret code? When …?

The issues in the preceding paragraph strongly suggest that it will prove problematic in the extreme to try to put precise times on the (supposed) occurrence of a proposition’s “becoming true.” Moreover, propositions are supposed to be abstract entities, entities which do not exist in space and time; but if they do not exist in time, how can their properties change – from being neither true nor false to being true (or to being false as the case may be) – at some particular time?

Second objection to Proposal One: We do, in a great many cases, routinely ascribe truth to propositions about future events. (iii) Each year the Children’s Hospital in Vancouver has a lottery in which the grand prize is a new “prestige home.” Persons buy tickets on the firm belief that some winning ticket will be drawn. If the Hospital deliberately failed to draw a ticket, on the scheduled date, from the pool of purchased tickets, all those who had purchased a ticket could rightly claim that the hospital had been lying (that is, had been asserting false propositions). The ticket-holders had all assumed that the proposition “Some winning ticket will be drawn on the scheduled date” was true, weeks before the scheduled date. (iv) It is true today that there will a US presidential election in 2048. And (v) it is demonstrably true now that there will be a total solar eclipse, over parts of Libya and Turkey, on 30 April 2060 (Brunier & Luminet, 2000, pp.154-5).

Third objection to Proposal One: To argue that propositions about the future acquire a truth-value only when the described event occurs (that is, in the future) will entail abandoning the logical law (/principle) of the excluded middle: propositions about the future will not, then, have truth-values now (that is, prior to the occurrence of the predicted event). Adopting Proposal One would require our creating a far more complicated logic. This is not to say that this proposed solution is completely without merit; but it is to say that we ought to try to find some other solution before resorting to such a major revision of logic. [For more discussion of these objections, see Time: Is Only the Present Real?.]

What other way might one, then, propose to avoid the conclusion of the argument about tomorrow’s sea battle?

Proposal Two: Disjunctions (that is, propositions of the form “P or Q” [in this particular case “A wins or it is false that A wins”]) are true, but not the individual disjuncts (components, that is, “A wins” and “it is false that A wins”).

Objection to Proposal Two: The proposal is terribly peculiar. We are inclined to say that a disjunction is true just because (at least) one of its disjuncts is true. If neither P is true nor Q is true, how can “P or Q” be true? And, further, just as in the previous proposal, this one, too, entails abandoning the law of the excluded middle: while “A wins or it is false that A wins” has a truth-value now, neither of the two propositions “A wins” and “it is false that A wins” has a truth-value now. So, once again, we would prefer a less radical solution.

Interim Conclusion #1: It emerges, then, that challenging the premises of the argument for logical determinism – namely that a proposition about an event can be true prior to the occurrence of that event – is not a promising approach to solving the problem of the threat posed to the existence of free will. (We will return to a further examination of Logical Determinism in due course.) Since truth is a necessary condition for knowledge, if we had been able to reject the premises of the argument for logical determinism, we would, thereby, at a stroke have undercut the argument for epistemic determinism. But, at this point in our discussions, we are allowing that future contingents can be true (or false) now, prior to the events referred to. Thus we must next examine whether the premises of the argument for epistemic determinism can be true.

b. Can a Future Contingent be known prior to the event it refers to?

How might one try to rebut the premises of the argument for epistemic determinism?

Proposal One: One might argue that factual propositions are knowable only through a causal chain linking the event to the would-be knower. One can know, for example, that Mount St. Helens erupted within the last one hundred years: by hearing the reports of eyewitnesses, by seeing the event on television, by reading newspaper accounts, and by viewing the very considerable damage to the environs of the mountain. In short, we know of events by their causal remnants and since there apparently are no cases of ‘backwards causation’, knowledge of future contingents is impossible.

Objection to Proposal One: Even if it is granted that there are no causal remnants of future events, the conclusion that there can be no knowledge of future events is false. Examining their remnants is not the only way to have knowledge of future events. In the case of Mount St. Helens, for example, ample warning was given (a month earlier) by the US Forestry Service of the imminent cataclysm. Some of those who choose to ignore the danger signals did not live long to regret their folly.

And it is not only of impending large-scale disasters that we often have foreknowledge. Throughout our normal, even humdrum, days we depend on our knowledge of future contingents in order to maintain our lives and to avert death. When we see a bus traveling at a high speed along a highway on whose curb we are standing, we know full well that that bus is going to pass in front of us and that it would kill us if we were to be foolhardy enough to step in front of it just as it approached. None of us expects the bus suddenly, as it approaches, to turn into a slow-moving marshmallow. We know that the bus will retain its ‘integrity’ as a bus. Even such a simple, commonplace, act as unceremoniously opening and drinking a bottle of cola requires our knowing that it will not poison us, that it is, and will remain, potable.

Simply put, our knowledge of how the world has behaved up till now provides powerful evidence of how it will behave. That is why we teach our children not to play in the street, why we teach our children not to put their fingers into electrical outlets, why we (try to) teach our children not to drive while intoxicated, etc. Our daily behavior provides abundant and powerful evidence that we do, to a very great extent, know perfectly well what the future will be.

Proposal Two: The examples offered in the objection (immediately above) are not bona fide cases of foreknowledge; they are cases merely of strong beliefs. We may believe we know, but something ‘could go wrong’ between now and the predicted event. We cannot rule out our making a mistake. There is always the ineliminable possibility of error. For example, the person who opens and drinks a bottle of cola doesn’t really know that it is safe to drink, that someone hasn’t in fact tampered with the drink and poisoned it. Because of the possibility of unforeseen circumstances, even if they are very improbable, one cannot have genuine knowledge of the future.

First Objection to Proposal Two: Knowing a future contingent does not require that there be no possibility of our making a error. Yes, we could make a mistake, yes, something might happen that will make our prediction turn out false, but that is no reason to claim that we cannot know the future. What is required is that we have good grounds to make our prediction and that they be true, not that there be no possibility of error.

At the dawn of the ‘modern’ era in philosophy, René Descartes (1595-1649) began his Meditations by asking what could be known for certain. He sets as his program the elimination from his belief-system all that is not, or cannot be, known for certain.

My reason tells me that as well as withholding assent from propositions that are obviously false, I should also withhold it from ones that are not completely certain and indubitable. (Descartes, 1641, p. 1)

Given the tenor of his time, with the extraordinary success of the ‘new’ science, the headiness of such a claim is perhaps understandable (and forgivable). But it was, in the end, a colossal error. It was the pursuit of an impossible goal, the philosophical equivalent of placing the goalposts in an unreachable place.

The two phrases “x knows” and “x knows for certain” are no more equivalent than “x sees the distant mountain” and “x sees the distant mountain perfectly (for example, from miles away x can see the veins in the leaves on the trees)”. Persons who do not have perfect pitch may, nonetheless, know when a pianist has hit a wrong note. One doesn’t have to hear perfectly to hear. Two mathematicians may prove the same theorem; one of these proofs may be ‘elegant’, the other ‘circuitous’; but both are proofs. A proof need not be elegant in order to be proof.

Similarly with knowledge. What one knows need not be certain; some, probably most, things that we know fall short of certainty, but it is arbitrary and stultifying to refuse to acknowledge these cases as genuine cases of knowledge. By setting the standards too high, as did Descartes and as do many of his intellectual heirs even today, is to rob the concept of “knowledge” of its utility.

To know the future, it is not required that we be infallible (that is, incapable of making a mistake). The person who sees a bus fast approaching knows that it will not (miraculously) turn into a marshmallow. And she is right: it does not. Realistically, few of us (unless corrupted by a bad introductory philosophy course), would be tempted to say, “She didn’t know. After all, the bus could have turned into a marshmallow.” True enough, there is one sensein which the bus could have turned into a marshmallow, and that sense is that such an eventuality is a logical possibility (that is, is not logically self-contradictory). Indeed it is a matter of the very definition of “matter of fact” or “contingency” that such propositions are both possibly true and possibly false. Every true contingency is (as a matter of the very definition of “contingency”) possibly false; and likewise every false contingency is (as a matter of the very definition of “contingency”) possibly true. [More on this in section 5 below.] But nothing of particular significance follows from these latter facts.

One must be careful not to ‘slide’ from “possible” to “probable”. Just because an event is possible does not justify the inference that it is probable. The proposition that the US Congress will adopt Swedish as the country’s sole national language certainly is a logical possibility (that is, is not self-contradictory). But that proposition has a probability, for all intents and purposes, of zero. Every contingent proposition is both possibly true and possibly false. And some propositions that are possibly false have a reasonably high probability of being actually true; while some (other) possibly false propositions have a (nearly) zero probability (/zero likelihood) of being true. The essential point for our knowing a contingent proposition is (a) our having a well-founded belief that it is true and (b) that it is true. Its being possibly false is irrelevant. Its being probably false is quite another matter, but whether it is probably false or is not probably false is not entailed by its being possibly false.

Every true contingency whatsoever, not just those about the future, is possibly false. It is truth that counts, not possible falsehood. Actual truth ‘trumps’ possible falsehood in the matter of a proposition’s being known.

Second Objection to Proposal Two: One must be careful not to set the requirements, for knowing the future, unrealistically high. For such standards can rebound and make it impossible to know the past as well.

In the first decade of the Twentieth Century, the conductor and musicologist, Friedrich Wilhelm Stein, discovered in Jena, Germany, a copyist’s version of a formerly unknown symphony. The copyist had annotated it as having been written by Beethoven. It was published in 1911 as Beethoven’s “Jena Symphony”. However, in 1957, H.C. Robbins Landon uncovered the original manuscript and established that the composition had in fact been written by Friedrich Witt (1770-1837), a contemporary of Beethoven’s.

Clearly those who believed, in the years 1911 through 1947, that the “Jena Symphony” had been composed by Beethoven had a well-grounded belief. But, as it was to turn out, their belief was mistaken. And this little piece of history demonstrates how what we take to be knowledge of past events can be mistaken. But what moral should one draw from this story?

Although we can never eliminate entirely the possibility of our having mistaken beliefs about past events, or misleading (or incorrect) evidence for those beliefs, it does not follow that we do not have knowledge of a great many past events. There is, to cite just one instance, simply too much evidence, indeed overwhelming evidence, that Mount St. Helens erupted on 18 May 1980 for anyone to have a rational belief that we do not know that historical fact. To be sure, it is logically possible that we should be mistaken. But the probability that we are mistaken is effectively zero.

If we are to be skeptical about the possibility of knowing any future events, we would have to be equally skeptical of our knowledge of the past. And if we are not unduly skeptical about our knowledge of the past, we ought not to be unduly skeptical about the possibility of our knowing certain future events. (And as for the claim that we know far more about the past than we do of the future, one must bear in mind that we know only an infinitesimal part of what has happened in the past. Do you know, or indeed have any way of finding out, for example, the names of Leif Ericson’s shipmates?)

Understand that I am not being especially skeptical about the past. All I am trying to do is to draw a parallel between knowledge of the past and knowledge of the future. The parallels are these: in both sorts of cases it is possible to have very strong evidence; in both sorts of cases it is possible to be mistaken. Possibly being mistaken is not a condition unique to claims about knowing the future; it applies equally to claims about knowing the past. But in neither case does the possibility of error undermine truth.

Proposal Three: The examples that have been given of foreknowledge (for example, of a solar eclipse) of an imminent volcanic eruption, of a US presidential election, etc., are cases of naturally occurring phenomena or of legislatively mandated events. Such events have an overwhelmingly high probability of occurring. But when we turn to cases of human beings making choices, the situation is vastly different.

Many, perhaps most, human choices and behaviors are the product of free will. Some of these choices and behaviors are conscious and deliberative considerations; others are subject to whim, to irrational desires, to spur-of-the-moment decisions, etc. None of us can know, in advance, what another person’s free choice will be.

Objections to Proposal Three: This latter way of trying to undercut the premises of the argument for Epistemic Determinism works, if at all, only for the secular version. It does nothing to diminish the sting of the version capitalizing on God’s omniscience.

But even if this objection is confined to the secular version, it hardly addresses the alleged conundrum. For the secular version of the argument for Epistemic Determinism does not, in the slightest, require that we human beings be able to foresee all the actions and behavior of other persons. The argument has its dreadful bite even if we are able to foresee only some of the free choices of others. And being able to do that is something that is familiar to everyone.

In the case of persons whom we know well, especially family members, we are able to know, in certain circumstances, what they are about to say or do. If my wife and I go to dinner at one particular restaurant, I know beforehand, without her telling me, what she will order for dessert (lemon pie). If I happen to glance at her shopping list before she leaves home, I can know in advance that she will return with some 60-watt light bulbs. All of these are free choices on her part; none of them is coerced or forced in any way. Yet, I do know them.

In the case of predicting the behavior of groups of persons, entire industries have grown up in the last 100 years devoted to such inquiries: professional pollsters, of course, but also economists, psychologists, political commentators, planning departments of large corporations, marketing advisers, pension-fund managers, etc., operating under a number of context-relevant constraints (for example, to minimize losses) to maximize gains, etc. Perhaps nowhere is such research of greater consequence than in planning military maneuvers (as in World War II). On that occasion, it became a matter of life and death for countless numbers of troops that their commanders correctly predicted the actions of their enemies.

Interim Conclusion #2:

Earlier we saw that there are no good reasons to reject the claim that future contingents are true (or false as the case may be) prior to the occurrence of the events they refer to. And now we see that, similarly, there are no good reasons to reject the claim that many future contingents (all future contingents in the case of God) can be, and more especially are, known prior to the events they refer to.

Thus, if we are, finally, to remove the sting of the deterministic arguments, we will have to do so by arguing that these arguments, although having true premises, are – appearances to the contrary – invalid. Each of these arguments harbors a logical slip between their premises and their conclusions. The rest of this article is given over to revealing the nature of the logical error.

5. Possibility, Necessity, and Contingency

To expose the mistakes in the deterministic arguments, we will need some tools of modern logic. Some elementary symbols will help to illuminate the concepts at play in the deterministic arguments. However, all the formulas that will be used, which incorporate these symbols, will also be expressed in English prose.

Symbol	Its meaning	Explanation
P, Q, R, …	propositions	See (see Sec. 2 of Truth)
~P	it is not the case that P	Example: It is not the case that copper conducts electricity. (Note: “P” and “~P” have opposite truth-values – whichever is true, the other is false.)
P ⊃ Q	if P, then Q	Example: If she is late, (then) the meeting will be delayed.
gKP	God knows that P	Example: God knows that the Mississippi River flows north to south.

Next we need three concepts at the heart of modern modal logic. The symbols are:

Symbol	Its meaning	Explanation
◊P	it is (logically) possible that P	Example: It is (logically) possible that the United States was defeated in World War II. (Note: Whatever is not self-contradictory is logically possible.)
☐P	It is (logically) necessary that P	Example: It is logically necessary that every number has a double. (Note: If Q is not logically possible, then ~Q is logically necessary.)
∇P	It is contingent that P	Example: It is contingent that the United States purchased Alaska from Russia. (Note: A proposition, Q, is contingent if and only if ◊Q and ◊~Q.)

These latter three concepts require further elaboration.

P is possible (symbolized “◊P”). A proposition, P, is possible if and only if it is not self-contradictory. All propositions that are true are possibly true. In addition, some false propositions are also possibly true, namely those that are false but are not self-contradictory. Some philosophers like to explicate “P is possible” in this way: “There are some possible circumstances in which P is true”. And some philosophers, adopting the terminology popularized by Leibniz (1646-1716), will substitute “worlds” for “circumstances”, yielding “P is true in some possible worlds”. Examples of possibly true propositions include:

Ottawa, Canada, is north of Washington, DC.
The Great Salt Lake is saltier than the Dead Sea.
The Dead Sea is saltier than the Great Salt Lake.
John Lennon was the first songwriter to travel in a space capsule.
There are three times as many species of insect as there are species of mollusk.
2 + 2 = 4
All aunts are female.
Some pigs can levitate.

Understand that prefacing a proposition, P, with “◊” does not ‘make’ P possible. What it does is to create a new, different, proposition, namely ◊P, which, in effect, says that P is possible. If P is possible (for example, suppose “P” stands for “Gold was first discovered in California in 1990”), then (although P is false), ◊P is true. Or, suppose “Q” stands for “2 + 2 = 7”. Then prefacing “Q” with “◊” does not ‘make’ Q possible. It produces a new proposition, “◊Q”, which is false. Q is, and remains, impossible whether or not it is prefaced with “◊”.

Everything that is actual (or actually true) is possible (that is, possibly true). But if a proposition is actually false, then it is impossible only if it is self-contradictory; otherwise it is a false contingency, and all contingencies, whether true or false, are possible.

We may ask “What color did Sylvia paint the lawn chair?” We look at the chair and see that she has painted it yellow. Thus it is demonstrable that it is possible that she painted the chair yellow. And its being yellow implies it is false that she painted the chair blue. But the falsity of the proposition that she painted the lawn chair blue in no way precludes that she could have done so. Even though false, it still remains possible that she painted the chair blue.

P is necessary (symbolized “☐P”). Necessarily true propositions are those that are true in all possible circumstances (/worlds)—that is, are not false in any. Necessary truth can be defined in terms of possibility, namely P is necessary if and only if its negation (that is, “~P”) is impossible. In symbols (where “=_df” stands for “is by definition”):

☐P =_df ~◊~P

Examples of necessarily true propositions:

2 + 2 = 4
All aunts are female.
Whatever is blue is colored.
There are either fewer than 20 million stars or there are more than 12 million. (This statement may be unobvious; but if you think about it you may come to see that it cannot be false.)
It is false that some triangle has exactly four sides.

P is contingent (symbolized “∇P”). A proposition, P, is contingent if and only if it is both possibly true andpossibly false. Contingent propositions are those that are true in some possible circumstances (/worlds) and are false in some possible circumstances (/worlds). Contingency can be defined in terms of possibility, namely:

∇P =_df ◊P & ◊~P

It is essential to understand that “◊P & ◊~P” does not mean “P is true and false in some possible circumstances (worlds)”. No proposition whatsoever is both true and false in the same set of circumstances (law of non-contradiction). To say that a proposition is contingent is to say that it is true in some possible circumstances and is false in some (other!) circumstances.

Examples:

The Boston Red Sox won the World Series in 2002.
It is false that the Boston Red Sox won the World Series in 2002.
Steel-clad ships can float in the ocean.
It is false that steel-clad ships can float in the ocean.

Modal terms and modal status

Terms such as “must”, “has to”, “cannot”, “is necessary”, “is impossible”, “could not be otherwise”, “has to be”, “might”, “could be”, “contingent”, and the like, are known as “modal” terms. All of these are definable in terms of “possibility”.

Every proposition is either logically possible or logically impossible. And no proposition is both.

Drawing the net a bit finer, and dividing the class of logically possible propositions into those that are necessarily true and those that are contingent, we have three exclusive categories. Every proposition is exclusively either necessarily true, necessarily false, or contingent. That is, every proposition falls into one of these latter three categories, and no proposition falls into more than one.

Just as the expression “truth-value” is a generic term encompassing “truth” and “falsity”, the expression “modal status” is a generic term encompassing “contingent”, “necessarily true”, and “necessarily false”.

Finally, no proposition ever changes its modal status. We will call this principle “The Principle of the Fixity of Modal Status“. And for the purposes of assessing the deterministic arguments we note especially: no contingent proposition ever ‘becomes’ necessary or impossible.

6. The Modal Fallacy

From a mathematical point of view, if we arbitrarily pick any two propositions, truth and falsity can be attributed to them in four different combinations, specifically

the first is true, and the second is true
the first is true, and the second is false
the first is false, and the second is true
the first is false, and the second is false

However, it sometimes happens that two propositions will have certain logical relationships between them such as to make one or more of these four combinations impossible. For example, consider the two propositions α and β.

α: Diane planted only six rosebushes.

β: Diane planted fewer than eight rosebushes.

While each of these propositions, by itself, could be true and could be false, there are – as it turns out – only three, not four, possible combinations of truth and falsity that can be attributed to this particular pair of propositions. On careful thought, we can see that the second combination – that is, the one which attributes truth to α and falsity to β – is impossible. For if α is true (that is, if it is true that Diane has planted only six rosebushes) then β is also true. Put another way: the truth of α guarantees the truth of β. This is to say

(1) It is impossible (for α to be true and for β to be false).

Unfortunately, ordinary English does not lend itself easily to express the quasi-symbolic sentence (1). In symbols we can express the sentence this way:

(1a) ~◊(α & ~β)

About the best we can do in English is to create the following unidiomatic, extremely clumsy sentence:

(1b) The compound sentence, α and not-β, is impossible (that is, is necessarily false).

English prose is a poor tool for expressing fine logical distinctions (just as it is an unsuitable tool for expressing fine mathematical distinctions^[3] ). But, as it turns out, the situation is worse than just having to make do with awkward sentences. For it is a curious fact about most natural languages – English, French, Hebrew, etc. – that when we use modal terms in ordinary speech, we often do so in logically misleading ways. Just see how natural it is to try to formulate the preceding point [namely proposition (1)] in this fashion:

(2) If α is true, then it is impossible for β to be false.

Or, in symbols:

(2a) α ⊃ ~◊~β

In ordinary speech, the latter sentence, (2), is natural and idiomatic; the former sentence (1b) is unnatural and unidiomatic. But – and this is the crucial point – the propositions expressed by (1)-(1b) are not equivalent to the propositions expressed by sentences (2)-(2a). The former set, that is (1)-(1b), are all true. The latter, (2)-(2a)are false and commit the modal fallacy. The fallacy occurs in its assigning the modality of impossibility, not to the relationship between the truth of α and falsity of β as is done in (1)-(1b), but to the falsity of β alone. Ordinary grammar beguiles us and misleads us. It makes us believe that if α is true, then it is impossible for β to be false. But it is possible for β to be false. β is a contingent proposition. Recall the principle of the fixity of modal status. Even if the falsity of β is guaranteed by the truth of some other proposition [in this case α], β does not ‘become’ impossible: it ‘remains’ contingent, and thereby possible.

Whatever impossibility there is lies in jointly asserting α and denying β. (See (1b) above.) The proposition “it is false that β” does not ‘become’ impossible if one asserts α.^[4]

a. The Modal Fallacy in Logical Determinism

Some persons have been deceived by the following (fallacious) argument to the effect that there are no contingent propositions:

“(By the Law of Non-contradiction), if a proposition is true (/false), then it cannot be false (/true). If a proposition cannot be false (/true), then it is necessarily true (/false). Therefore if a proposition is true (/false), it is necessarily true (/false). That is, there are no contingent propositions. Every proposition is either necessarily true or necessarily false. (If we could see the world from God’s viewpoint, we would see the necessity of everything. Contingency is simply an artifact of ignorance. Contingency disappears with complete knowledge.)”

The fallacy arises in the ambiguity of the first premise. If we interpret it close to the English, we get:

P ⊃ ~◊~P
~◊~P ⊃ ☐P
——————
∴ P ⊃ ☐ P

However, if we regard the English as misleading, as assigning a necessity to what is simply nothing more than a necessary condition, then we get instead as our premises:

~◊(P & ~P) [equivalently: ☐(P ⊃ P)]
~◊~P ⊃ ☐P

From these latter two premises, one cannot validly infer the conclusion:

P ⊃ ☐P.

In short, the argument to the effect that there are no contingent propositions is unsound. Its very first premise commits the
modal fallacy.

The identical error occurs in the argument for logical determinism. Recall (the expanded version of) Aristotle’s sea battle:

Two warring admirals, A and B, are preparing their fleets for a decisive sea battle tomorrow. The battle will be fought until one side is victorious. But the “logical laws (or principles)” of the excluded middle (every proposition is either true or false) and of noncontradiction (no proposition is both true and false), require that one of the propositions, “A wins” and “it is false that A wins,” is true and the other is false. Suppose “A wins” is (today) true. Then whatever A does (or fails to do) today will make no difference: A must win; similarly, whatever B does (or fails to do) today will make no difference: the outcome is already settled (that is, A must win). Or again, suppose “A wins” is (today) false. Then no matter what A does today (or fails to do), it will make no difference: A must lose; similarly, no matter what B does (or fails to do), it will make no difference: the outcome is already settled (that is, A must lose). Thus, if every proposition is either true or false (and not both), then planning, or as Aristotle put it “taking trouble,” is futile. The future will be what it will be, irrespective of our planning, intentions, etc.

If we let “A” stand for “Admiral A wins” and let “B” stand for “Admiral B wins”, the core of this argument can be stated in symbols this way:

A or B [one or the other of these two propositions is true]

~◊(A & B) [it is not possible that both A and B are true]

∴ A ⊃ ☐A
A ⊃ ~◊~A } If A is true, then A must be true.

If A is true, then A cannot be false.

A ⊃ ☐~B
A ⊃ ~◊B } If A is true, then B must be
false.If A is true, then B cannot be true.

B ⊃ ☐B
B ⊃ ~◊~B } If B is true, then B must be true.

If B is true, then B cannot be false.

B ⊃ ☐~A
B ⊃ ~◊A } If B is true, then A must be
false.If B is true, then A cannot be true.

In this argument, by hypothesis, either A is true or B is true, and since they cannot both be true, the second premise may be accepted as true. But none of the conclusions is true. A is contingent, and B is contingent. Yet the conclusions state that from the assumed truth of either of (the two contingencies) A or B, it follows that A and B are each either necessarily true or necessarily false. Each of these eight conclusions violates the principle of the fixity of modal status. What, then, are the conclusions one may draw validly from the premises? These:

☐(A ⊃ ~B) or, equivalently, ~◊(A & B)

☐(B ⊃ ~A) or, equivalently, ~◊(B & A)

So long as we remain mindful of the fact that “~◊(P & Q)” is logically equivalent to “☐(P ⊃ ~Q)” but is not equivalent to “P ⊃ ☐~Q”, the argument for logical determinism will be seen to be invalid. Our ordinary language treats “it is impossible for both P and Q to be true” as if it were logically equivalent to “if P is true, then Q is necessarily false”. But the profound difference between these two assertions is that the former preserves the principle of the fixity of modal status, the latter violates that principle. The proposition, “Admiral A wins”, is contingent, and if true, then it “remains” true. Indeed this is a trivial logical truth:

(i) ☐(P ⊃ P) alternatively, ~◊(P & ~P)

The argument for logical determinism illicitly treats this logical truth as if it were equivalent to the false proposition

(ii) P ⊃ ☐P alternatively, P ⊃ ~◊~P

If you do not let yourself be beguiled by the invalid ‘move’ (inference) from (i) to (ii), the argument for logical determinism collapses. The truth of a proposition concerning your future behavior does not make that future behavior necessary. What you choose to do in the future was, is, and will remain contingent, even if a proposition describing that choice is timelessly true.

b. The Modal Fallacy in Epistemic Determinism

Let’s recall Maimonides’s argument:

… “Does God know or does He not know that a certain individual will be good or bad? If thou sayest ‘He knows’, then it necessarily follows that [that] man is compelled to act as God knew beforehand he would act, otherwise God’s knowledge would be imperfect.”

We can symbolize the core of this argument, using “∴” for “it necessarily follows”; and “☐” for “compelled”; and “D” for the proposition describing what some particular person does tomorrow.

gKD
———
∴ ☐D

There seems to be (at least) one missing premise. [In the terminology of logicians, the argument is enthymematic.] One tacit assumption of this argument is the necessary truth, “it is not possible both for God to know that D and for D to be false”, or, in symbols, “~◊(gKD & ~D)”. So the argument becomes:

gKD
~◊(gKD & ~D)
————————
∴ ☐D

But even with this repair, the argument remains invalid. The conclusion does not follow from the two premises. To derive the conclusion, a third premise is needed, and it is easy to see what it is. Most persons, with hardly a moment’s thought, virtually as a reflex action, will tacitly assume that the second premise is logically equivalent to:

gKD ⊃ ☐D

and will tacitly (/unconsciously) add this further premise, so as to yield, finally:

gKD
~◊(gKD & ~D)
gKD ⊃ ☐D
————————
∴ ☐D

But this third premise, we have seen above, is false; it commits the modal fallacy. Without this premise, Maimonides’ argument is invalid; with it, the argument becomes valid but unsound (that is, has a false and essential premise [namely the third one]). Either way, the argument is a logical botch.

Once the logical error is detected, and removed, the argument for epistemic determinism simply collapses. If some future action/choice is known prior to its occurrence, that event does not thereby become “necessary”, “compelled”, “forced”, or what have you. Inasmuch as its description was, is, and will remain forever contingent, both it and its negation remain possible. Of course only one of the two was, is, and will remain true; while the other was, is, and will remain false. But truth and falsity, per se, do not determine a proposition’s modality. Whether true or false, each of these propositions was, is, and will remain possible. Knowing – whether by God or a human being – some future event no more forces that event to occur than our learning that dinosaurs lived in (what is now) South Dakota forced those reptiles to take up residence there.

7. Residual concerns – Changing the past; Changing the future

It will sometimes happen that persons will painstakingly follow each of the steps of the preceding arguments that expose the modal fallacy in logical and epistemic determinism and still harbor lingering worries that the truth or knowledge of future contingents precludes the very possibility of free will

“Look”, they might say, “if it is already true today (Monday) that I will do Z tomorrow (Tuesday), then surely tomorrow, try as I might, I will end up doing Z. Were I do something else instead, in effect not do Z on Tuesday, then I would change, from true to false, the truth-value that a proposition had on Monday. But that is impossible. Thus, tomorrow, my considering the alternatives – my deliberating over my course of action, my trying to make up my mind what I will choose, my trying to exercise free will – is really just an illusion. Since I can’t change the past, and since it is already true before I act that I will do Z, it clearly follows that I cannot exercise free will.”

To tackle this last deterministic argument, we need to discuss two matters: (1) what might be meant by the expressions “change the past” and “change the future”, and (2) whether changing the future involves retroactively changing the truth-value of a proposition.

Changing the past, present, or future: The past is fixed. One cannot undo what has happened (although one can, of course, try to mitigate the consequences of wrongful acts – by apologizing, making amends, etc.)

Not even an omnipotent God can ‘undo’ or ‘redo’ the past, for to do so would per impossible actualize a self-contradiction (for example, “x occurred at such-and-such a time and x did not occur at such and such a time”).

Jewish sages warn against ‘prayer in vain’ (where “in vain” does not mean “futile” but “contemptuously” or “profanely” [as in the Third Commandment, “Thou shalt not take the Lord’s name in vain”]):

… to cry over the past is to utter a vain prayer. If a man’s wife is [already] pregnant and he says, “[God] grant that my wife bear a male child”, this is a vain prayer. If he is coming home from a journey and he hears cries of distress in the town and says, “[God] grant that this is not in my house”, this is a vain prayer. (Epstein, 1948, pp. 327-8)

Such prayers were regarded as blasphemous since they were taken to be supplications to God that He change the past from the way it was. But not even an omnipotent God can violate the logical principle of the (law of) non-contradiction.

And yet, God-fearing persons frequently do utter such prayers. How natural it is, for example, for Believers, when knowing that their child was on board a particular ship, and learning that the ship has met a terrible calamity and sunk – with some passengers being lost and some others being rescued – to pray to God that their child is among the survivors. Is there any way to rationalize such behavior and render it non-blasphemous?

Modern modal logic again comes to the rescue. Remember, on traditional accounts, God is (along with being all-good) omniscient and omnipotent. God, being omniscient, will have known, since the beginning of time, that the parents would pray (at such and such a time) for the survival of their child. In particular, God would have known at the time of the ship’s sinking that the parents would pray sometime later, and God could have chosen to answer those prayers in advance of their being uttered. On this view, God is not changing the past at all; God is making the past one particular way among the infinite number of different ways it could have been. One must attend to the modalities. Under this view, God does not change the past from the way it was (which activity would be a violation of the principle of non-contradiction), but rather God makes one possibility (the child’s surviving) actual, and makes another possibility (the child’s perishing) nonactual. There is no violation of the principle of non-contradiction, and the parents’ prayers are not blasphemous.

And it bears emphasizing that it is not God’s knowing beforehand that the parents would pray in a certain manner that ‘brings it about’ (‘necessitates’, ‘forces’) their praying that way. It is, quite the contrary: it is the parents praying of their own free will that God have saved their child from death that moves God to do (have done) as he did.

Similar freedoms and constraints apply to the present. On pain of inconsistency, one cannot change what is happening at this very moment. In some circumstances, and in a certain sense, one can change what is about to happen next (that is, in the immediate future). But one cannot change what is happening now (that is, at this very moment).

What about the future? Most of us believe that we can, to a certain extent, change (or affect) the future. But then we recall the proverb, “Que sera, sera” (“What will be, will be”), and we begin to have doubts. If the future will be what it is going to be, how can we change it?

Not surprisingly, the response is: “It all depends on what you mean by ‘change'”.

“I cannot change the future – by anything I have done, am doing, or will do – from what it is going to be. But I can change the future from what it might have been. I may carefully consider the appearance of my garden, and after a bit of thought, mulling over a few alternatives, I decide to cut down the apple tree. By so doing, I change the future from what it might have been. But I do not change it from what it will be. Indeed, by my doing what I do, I contribute – in a small measure – to making the future the very way it will be.”Similarly, I cannot change the present from the way it is. I can only change the present from the way it might have been, from the way it would have been were I not doing what I am doing right now. And finally, I cannot change the past from the way it was. In the past, I changed it from what it might have been, from what it would have been had I not done what I did.

“We can change the world from what it might have been; but in doing that we contribute to making the world the way it was, is, and will be. We cannot – on pain of logical contradiction – change the world from the way it was, is, or will be.” (Swartz, 2001, pp. 226-227)

Suppose that tomorrow, by the exercise of my free will, I wash the family car. In doing so, I make the future just what it was to be. But it was to be (that way rather than some other) just because I will exercise my free will tomorrow. It is tomorrow’s exercise of my free will that makes it the way it will be.

In exercising my free will tomorrow (to wash the family car) have I retroactively changed the past? Have I changed the truth-value of some proposition from true to false and of some other proposition from false to true?

Semantic relations are not causal relations: Again, the English language confuses us. We say that what we willchoose to do tomorrow ‘makes‘ some proposition true. And we might add, what I choose to do tomorrow (namely wash the family car) ‘makes‘ the car clean.

But these are two radically different senses of “makes”. The first use of “makes” refers to the semantic relation of “truth-conferring”. My washing the car tomorrow ‘confers’ truth on the proposition that on such-and-such a day, I wash the family car. But an event’s ‘conferring truth’ on a proposition is not a causal relation. Causal relations occur between two events (or occurrences, or states). The event of my washing the car brings about the state (or the event that lasts several days) of my car being clean.

The event of my washing the car tomorrow doesn’t retroactively cause the proposition that I wash the car tomorrow to become true, nor does it change the truth-value of that proposition. The proposition that I wash the car tomorrow (that is, on such-and-such a date) simply describes what happens tomorrow. If I do wash the car tomorrow, then that proposition was, is, and forever will be, true. If I do not wash the car tomorrow, then that same proposition was, is, and always will be false.

Some persons find it easier to understand the concept of the semantic relation of ‘truth-making’ if the example concerns a past event rather than a future one. Consider the proposition (which is still being debated by scientists) that the dinosaurs on earth perished as a result of an impact of a huge meteor at Chicxulub, on the Yucatan Peninsula in Mexico, about 65 million years ago. If there was such an impact, and if it caused the demise of the dinosaurs, then the proposition is true (or, more specifically, always was, is, and always will be true). If, however, there was no such impact, or if there was an impact but it didn’t cause the death of the dinosaurs, then the proposition always was, is, and forever will be false.

Every actual event has a timelessly true description. It is what happens (that is, what events occur)—including those that are the free choices of human beings—that “accounts for” the truth of their descriptions. The truth (today) of the proposition that John Wilkes Booth assassinated Abraham Lincoln neither ‘accounts for’ nor ’caused’ that criminal act.

In the next few hours I will make any number of free choices. Tomorrow there will be true propositions describing those choices. But none of my choices today is ‘forced’ or ’caused by’ my actual choices having true descriptions tomorrow. And we can generalize:

In the next few hours you will exercise your free will and make any number of free choices. Yesterday there were, today there are, and tomorrow there will be, true propositions describing those choices. But none of your choices today (whatever they are) is ‘forced’ or ’caused by’ your actual choices having had a true description yesterday, having a true description today, or continuing to have a true description tomorrow.

8. Concluding Remarks

The argument (Logical Determinism) that a proposition’s being true prior to the occurrence of the event it describes logically precludes free will ultimately rests on a modal fallacy. And the ancillary argument that a proposition’s being true prior to the occurrence of the event it describes causes the future event to occur turns on a confusion (i) of the truth-making (semantic) relation between an event and its description with (ii) the causal relation between two events.

The argument (Epistemic Determinism) that a proposition’s being known prior to the occurrence of the event it describes logically precludes free will, as in the case of logical determinism, ultimately rests on a modal fallacy. And the arguments that it is impossible to know the future are refuted by two facts. One is that we do in fact know a very great deal about the future, indeed our managing to keep ourselves alive from hour to hour, from day to day, depends to a very great extent on such knowledge. Two is that the objection that we cannot have knowledge of the future – because our beliefs about the future ‘might’ (turn out to) be false – turns on a mistaken account of the role of ‘the possibility of error’ in a viable account of knowledge. Beliefs about future actions, insofar as they are contingent, and – by the very definition of “contingency” – are possibly false. But “possibly false” does not mean “probably false”, and possibly false beliefs, so long as they are also actually true, can constitute bona fide knowledge of the future.

9. References and Further Reading

a. References

Aristotle (1963). Categories and De Interpretatione, translated with notes by J.L. Ackrill (Oxford: Clarendon Press), Chapter 9 (pp. 50-53).
Bradley, Raymond and Norman Swartz (1979). Possible Worlds, (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co.).
Brunier, Serge and Jean-Pierre Luminet (2000). Glorious Eclipses: Their Past, Present and Future, translated by Storm Dunlop (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press), pp.154-5.
Descartes, René (1641/1966). Meditations on First Philosophy (1641). Re-written (2004) by Jonathan Bennett, for readability by students in the 21st century, from the translation by John Cottingham (Cambridge University Press), 1996.
Epstein, Isidore (trans.) (1948). The Babylonian Talmud, Tractate Berakoth, Chapter IX., (London: The Soncino Press [Oxford]). (Reprinted in 1978.)
Gettier, Edmund L. (1963). “Is Knowledge Justified True Belief?” Analysis 23, pp. 121-123.
Hempel, Carl (1942). “The Function of General Laws in History,” The Journal of Philosophy 39, pp. 35-48.
- Reprinted in Aspects of Scientific Explanation, (NY: The Free Press), 1965,pp. 231-243.
Maimonides, Moses (1996). The Eight Chapters of Maimonides on Ethics (Semonah Perak.im), edited, annotated, and translated with an Introduction by Joseph I. Gorfinkle (New York: AMS Press).
Nagel, Ernest (1956). “Symbolic Notation, Haddocks’ Eyes and the Dog-Walking Ordinance” The World of Mathematics, vol. 3, edited by James R. Newman (NY: Simon and Schuster), pp. 1878-1900. (Reissued by Dover Publications, ISBN: 0486432688.)
Scriven, Michael (1965). “An Essential Unpredictability in Human Behavior,” in Scientific Psychology: Principles and Approaches, edited by Ernest Nagel and Benjamin Wolman, (New York: Basic Books), pp. 411-25.
Swartz, Norman (2001). Beyond Experience, 2nd edition.
Thomson, Judith Jarvis (1971). “The Time of a Killing,” Journal of Philosophy, 68 (1971), pp. 115-32.

b. Further Reading

Complementary

Craig, William Lane (1987). The Only Wise God: The Compatibility of Divine Foreknowledge and Human Freedom, (Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Book House).
Rowe, William L. (1993). Philosophy of Religion: An Introduction, 2nd edition (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth Publishing Co.), esp. Chapter 11, “Predestination, Divine Foreknowledge, and Human Freedom,” pp. 141-154.

Dissenting

Nelson Pike has argued that if one adopts a particular notion of omniscience [different from the one presupposed in this article], God’s omniscience does preclude the existence of human free will. Alvin Plantinga responds to Pike, arguing that God’s omniscience is compatible with human free will. Finally, Pike tries to defend his position against Plantinga. The three papers are:

Pike, Nelson (1965). “Divine Omniscience and Voluntary Action,” The Philosophical Review, 74 (Jan.) pp. 27-46.
- Reprinted as “God’s Foreknowledge and Human Free Will Are Incompatible,” in Philosophy of Religion: An Anthology, 2nd edition, edited by Louis P. Pojman, (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth Publishing Co.), 1994, pp. 250-60.
Pike, Nelson (1977). “Divine Foreknowledge, Human Freedom and Possible Worlds,” The Philosophical Review, 86 (April), pp. 209-216.
Plantinga, Alvin (1974). “God’s Foreknowledge and Human Free Will are Compatible,” God, Freedom, and Evil, (New York: Harper & Row), pp. 66-72.
- Reprinted in Philosophy of Religion: An Anthology, 2nd edition, edited by Louis P. Pojman, (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth Publishing Co.), 1994, pp. 261-4.

Supplementary: Causal Determinism

Throughout this article we have examined two alleged threats to the claim that human beings have free will, namely, the threat posed by Logical Determinism and that posed by Epistemic Determinism. Early we hived off the discussion of Causal Determinism. For many thinkers, causal determinism poses a far greater threat to the existence of free will than does either logical or epistemic determinism. Again, as a starting point, consider reading the article, “Laws of Nature” in this Encyclopedia.

Advanced

All three deterministic arguments are challenges to the thesis that human beings have free will. And enormous efforts have been expended over the last millennium, by countless philosophers and theologians, to rebut these arguments. All these efforts have been, as it were, defensive moves. And thus the question naturally arises: Is there, or can there even be, arguments to the effect that free will does exist? Is there any empirical evidence that human beings have the capacity to exercise free choice? Is the claim demonstrable that we can, at least on occasion, make free choices?

In his article, “An Essential Unpredictability in Human Behavior” (1965), Michael Scriven describes a thought-experiment which strongly supports the claim that we have free will. (See especially Section I., pp. 419-20.) Most persons will need to read this paper several times, and without a dismissive attitude, to plumb its cogency and depth. The paper is undeniably tough going, but, in the end, worth the effort needed to grasp its insights.

10. Notes

Although contemporary (twentieth- and twenty-first-century) secular philosophers continue the historical tradition of talking about God as a (/the) omniscient being, one should not thereby infer that these philosophers are assuming that God exists. For contemporary secular philosophers, “God” may be regarded as shorthand for “omniscient being.” Their interest is in the consequences of positing an omniscient being, not in promoting a belief that such a being exists. The latter is a quite different matter, not touched upon in this article. [ Return ]
This second condition is stated loosely. Indeed, ever since Gettier (1963), a number of philosophers have tried “tightening” the conditions that are necessary for knowledge. However, for our purposes, we need not settle on whether these conditions are sufficient for knowledge. For the present discussion, we need only insist upon the first condition (namely P is true), a condition that has been little challenged in late-twentieth- and early twenty-first-century theory of knowledge. [ Return ]
Just as an exercise, try to state the following formula solely in English prose:

x = [√(y² + z^√w)] / [2.7w (a^{3 + log(y – 0.5z)})]

For further illustrations of the difficulty on occasion of expressing fine logical points in ordinary prose, see Ernest Nagel’s celebrated “Symbolic Notation, Haddocks’ Eyes and the Dog-Walking Ordinance” (1956), especially the latter section. [ Return ]
The modal fallacy is hardly the only case of human beings’ susceptibility to logical error. Another logical error, this one drawn from mathematics, which – like the modal fallacy – took centuries to be corrected, has to do with the number of numbers. If one were to ask most persons, “Are there more even and odd positive integers (1, 2, 3, 4, …) than there are even positive integers (2, 4, 6, 8, …) alone?”, one would likely get as an answer, “Yes, of course.” There are twice as many even and odd positive integers together as there are even positive integers alone.” But contrary to our untutored intuitions, this is the wrong answer. It turns out, as was discovered and proved in the 19th century (by Georg Cantor [1845-1918]), there are exactly as many even positive integers as there are even and odd together. The two classes, that of all the positive integers and that of the even positive integers are said to be “equinumerous,” that is, both classes contain the same number (cardinality) of members, namely an infinite number. That there are as many even positive integers as there are positive integers can be demonstrated by the fact that the members of the two classes can be uniquely ‘paired off’, or putting the point in more technical jargon, the members of the two classes can be put into a “one-to-one correspondence”:

1 2 3 4 . . . .

| | | | | | etc.

2 4 6 8 . . . .

Every positive integer has a unique double; and every even positive integer has a unique half which is also an integer. Clearly, there are instances when some of our untutored, deeply ingrained, logical (and mathematical) “intuitions” need to be reformed.[ Return ]

Author Information

Norman Swartz
Email: swartz@sfu.ca
Simon Fraser University
Canada

Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889—1951)

Ludwig Wittgenstein is one of the most influential philosophers of the twentieth century, and regarded by some as the most important since Immanuel Kant. His early work was influenced by that of Arthur Schopenhauer and, especially, by his teacher Bertrand Russell and by Gottlob Frege, who became something of a friend. This work culminated in the Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, the only philosophy book that Wittgenstein published during his lifetime. It claimed to solve all the major problems of philosophy and was held in especially high esteem by the anti-metaphysical logical positivists. The Tractatus is based on the idea that philosophical problems arise from misunderstandings of the logic of language, and it tries to show what this logic is. Wittgenstein’s later work, principally his Philosophical Investigations, shares this concern with logic and language, but takes a different, less technical, approach to philosophical problems. This book helped to inspire so-called ordinary language philosophy. This style of doing philosophy has fallen somewhat out of favor, but Wittgenstein’s work on rule-following and private language is still considered important, and his later philosophy is influential in a growing number of fields outside philosophy.

Life
Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus
Ethics and Religion
Conception of Philosophy
Meaning
Rules and Private Language
Realism and Anti-Realism
Certainty
Continuity
Wittgenstein in History
References and Further Reading

1. Life

Ludwig Josef Johann Wittgenstein, born on April 26th 1889 in Vienna, Austria, was a charismatic enigma. He has been something of a cult figure but shunned publicity and even built an isolated hut in Norway to live in complete seclusion. His sexuality was ambiguous but he was probably gay; how actively so is still a matter of controversy. His life seems to have been dominated by an obsession with moral and philosophical perfection, summed up in the subtitle of Ray Monk’s excellent biography Wittgenstein: The Duty of Genius.

His concern with moral perfection led Wittgenstein at one point to insist on confessing to several people various sins, including that of allowing others to underestimate the extent of his ‘Jewishness’. His father Karl Wittgenstein’s parents were born Jewish but converted to Protestantism and his mother Leopoldine (nee Kalmus) was Catholic, but her father was of Jewish descent. Wittgenstein himself was baptized in a Catholic church and was given a Catholic burial, although between baptism and burial he was neither a practicing nor a believing Catholic.

The Wittgenstein family was large and wealthy. Karl Wittgenstein was one of the most successful businessmen in the Austro-Hungarian Empire, leading the iron and steel industry there. The Wittgensteins’ home attracted people of culture, especially musicians, including the composer Johannes Brahms, who was a friend of the family. Music remained important to Wittgenstein throughout his life. So did darker matters. Ludwig was the youngest of eight children, and of his four brothers, three committed suicide.

As for his career, Wittgenstein studied mechanical engineering in Berlin and in 1908 went to Manchester, England to do research in aeronautics, experimenting with kites. His interest in engineering led to an interest in mathematics which in turn got him thinking about philosophical questions about the foundations of mathematics. He visited the mathematician and philosopher Gottlob Frege (1848-1925), who recommended that he study with Bertrand Russell (1872-1970) in Cambridge. At Cambridge Wittgenstein greatly impressed Russell and G.E. Moore (1873- 1958), and began work on logic.

When his father died in 1913 Wittgenstein inherited a fortune, which he quickly gave away. When war broke out the next year, he volunteered for the Austrian army. He continued his philosophical work and won several medals for bravery during the war. The result of his thinking on logic was the Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus which was eventually published in English in 1922 with Russell’s help. This was the only book Wittgenstein published during his lifetime. Having thus, in his opinion, solved all the problems of philosophy, Wittgenstein became an elementary school teacher in rural Austria, where his approach was strict and unpopular, but apparently effective. He spent 1926-28 meticulously designing and building an austere house in Vienna for his sister Gretl.

In 1929 he returned to Cambridge to teach at Trinity College, recognizing that in fact he had more work to do in philosophy. He became professor of philosophy at Cambridge in 1939. During World War II he worked as a hospital porter in London and as a research technician in Newcastle. After the war he returned to university teaching but resigned his professorship in 1947 to concentrate on writing. Much of this he did in Ireland, preferring isolated rural places for his work. By 1949 he had written all the material that was published after his death as Philosophical Investigations, arguably his most important work. He spent the last two years of his life in Vienna, Oxford and Cambridge and kept working until he died of prostate cancer in Cambridge in April 1951. His work from these last years has been published as On Certainty. His last words were, “Tell them I’ve had a wonderful life.”

2. Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus

Wittgenstein told Ludwig von Ficker that the point of the Tractatus was ethical. In the preface to the book he says that its value consists in two things: “that thoughts are expressed in it” and “that it shows how little is achieved when these problems are solved.” The problems he refers to are the problems of philosophy defined, we may suppose, by the work of Frege and Russell, and perhaps also Schopenhauer. At the end of the book Wittgenstein says “My propositions serve as elucidations in the following way: anyone who understands me eventually recognizes them as nonsensical” [emphasis added]. What to make of the Tractatus, its author, and the propositions it contains, then, is no easy matter.

The book certainly does not seem to be about ethics. It consists of numbered propositions in seven sets. Proposition 1.2 belongs to the first set and is a comment on proposition 1. Proposition 1.21 is about proposition 1.2, and so on. The seventh set contains only one proposition, the famous “What we cannot speak about we must pass over in silence.”

Some important and representative propositions from the book are these:

1 The world is all that is the case.
4.01 A proposition is a picture of reality.
4.0312 …My fundamental idea is that the ‘logical constants’ are not representatives; that there can be no representatives of the logic of facts.
4.121 …Propositions show the logical form of reality. They display it.
4.1212 What can be shown, cannot be said.
4.5 …The general form of a proposition is: This is how things stand.
5.43 …all the propositions of logic say the same thing, to wit nothing.
5.4711 To give the essence of a proposition means to give the essence of all description, and thus the essence of the world.
5.6 The limits of my language mean the limits of my world.

Here and elsewhere in the Tractatus Wittgenstein seems to be saying that the essence of the world and of life is: This is how things are. One is tempted to add “–deal with it.” That seems to fit what Cora Diamond has called his “accept and endure” ethics, but he says that the propositions of the Tractatus are meaningless, not profound insights, ethical or otherwise. What are we to make of this?

Many commentators ignore or dismiss what Wittgenstein said about his work and its aims, and instead look for regular philosophical theories in his work. The most famous of these in the Tractatus is the “picture theory” of meaning. According to this theory propositions are meaningful insofar as they picture states of affairs or matters of empirical fact. Anything normative, supernatural or (one might say) metaphysical must, it therefore seems, be nonsense. This has been an influential reading of parts of the Tractatus. Unfortunately, this reading leads to serious problems since by its own lights the Tractatus’ use of words like “object,” “reality” and “world” is illegitimate. These concepts are purely formal or a priori. A statement such as “There are objects in the world” does not picture a state of affairs. Rather it is, as it were, presupposed by the notion of a state of affairs. The “picture theory” therefore denies sense to just the kind of statements of which the Tractatus is composed, to the framework supporting the picture theory itself. In this way the Tractatus pulls the rug out from under its own feet.

If the propositions of the Tractatus are nonsensical then they surely cannot put forward the picture theory of meaning, or any other theory. Nonsense is nonsense. However, this is not to say that the Tractatus itself is without value. Wittgenstein’s aim seems to have been to show up as nonsense the things that philosophers (himself included) are tempted to say. Philosophical theories, he suggests, are attempts to answer questions that are not really questions at all (they are nonsense), or to solve problems that are not really problems. He says in proposition 4.003 that:

Most of the propositions and questions of philosophers arise from our failure to understand the logic of our language. (They belong to the same class as the question whether the good is more or less identical than the beautiful.) And it is not surprising that the deepest problems are in fact not problems at all.

Philosophers, then, have the task of presenting the logic of our language clearly. This will not solve important problems but it will show that some things that we take to be important problems are really not problems at all. The gain is not wisdom but an absence of confusion. This is not a rejection of philosophy or logic. Wittgenstein took philosophical puzzlement very seriously indeed, but he thought that it needed dissolving by analysis rather than solving by the production of theories. The Tractatus presents itself as a key for untying a series of knots both profound and highly technical.

3. Ethics and Religion

Wittgenstein had a lifelong interest in religion and claimed to see every problem from a religious point of view, but never committed himself to any formal religion. His various remarks on ethics also suggest a particular point of view, and Wittgenstein often spoke of ethics and religion together. This point of view or attitude can be seen in the four main themes that run through Wittgenstein’s writings on ethics and religion: goodness, value or meaning are not to be found in the world; living the right way involves acceptance of or agreement with the world, or life, or God’s will, or fate; one who lives this way will see the world as a miracle; there is no answer to the problem of life–the solution is the disappearance of the problem.

Certainly Wittgenstein worried about being morally good or even perfect, and he had great respect for sincere religious conviction, but he also said, in his 1929 lecture on ethics, that “the tendency of all men who ever tried to write or talk Ethics or Religion was to run against the boundaries of language,” i.e. to talk or write nonsense. This gives support to the view that Wittgenstein believed in mystical truths that somehow cannot be expressed meaningfully but that are of the utmost importance. It is hard to conceive, though, what these ‘truths’ might be.

An alternative view is that Wittgenstein believed that there is really nothing to say about ethics. This would explain why he wrote less and less about ethics as his life wore on. His “accept and endure” attitude and belief in going “the bloody hard way” are evident in all his work, especially after the Tractatus. Wittgenstein wants his reader not to think (too much) but to look at the “language games” (any practices that involve language) that give rise to philosophical (personal, existential, spiritual) problems. His approach to such problems is painstaking, thorough, open-eyed and receptive. His ethical attitude is an integral part of his method and shows itself as such.

But there is little to say about such an attitude short of recommending it. In Culture and Value p.29e Wittgenstein writes:

Rules of life are dressed up in pictures. And these pictures can only serve to describe what we are to do, not justify it. Because they could provide a justification only if they held good in other respects as well. I can say: “Thank these bees for their honey as though they were kind people who have prepared it for you”; that is intelligible and describes how I should like you to conduct yourself. But I cannot say: “Thank them because, look, how kind they are!”–since the next moment they may sting you.

In a world of contingency one cannot prove that a particular attitude is the correct one to take. If this suggests relativism, it should be remembered that it too is just one more attitude or point of view, and one without the rich tradition and accumulated wisdom, philosophical reasoning and personal experience of, say, orthodox Christianity or Judaism. Indeed crude relativism, the universal judgement that one cannot make universal judgements, is self- contradictory. Whether Wittgenstein’s views suggest a more sophisticated form of relativism is another matter, but the spirit of relativism seems far from Wittgenstein’s conservatism and absolute intolerance of his own moral shortcomings. Compare the tolerance that motivates relativism with Wittgenstein’s assertion to Russell that he would prefer “by far” an organization dedicated to war and slavery to one dedicated to peace and freedom. (This assertion, however, should not be taken literally: Wittgenstein was no war-monger and even recommended letting oneself be massacred rather than taking part in hand-to-hand combat. It was apparently the complacency, and perhaps the self-righteousness, of Russell’s liberal cause that Wittgenstein objected to.)

With regard to religion, Wittgenstein is often considered a kind of Anti-Realist (see below for more on this). He opposed interpretations of religion that emphasize doctrine or philosophical arguments intended to prove God’s existence, but was greatly drawn to religious rituals and symbols, and considered becoming a priest. He likened the ritual of religion to a great gesture, as when one kisses a photograph. This is not based on the false belief that the person in the photograph will feel the kiss or return it, nor is it based on any other belief. Neither is the kiss just a substitute for a particular phrase, like “I love you.” Like the kiss, religious activity does express an attitude, but it is not just the expression of an attitude in the sense that several other forms of expression might do just as well. There might be no substitute that would do. The same might be said of the whole language-game (or games) of religion, but this is a controversial point. If religious utterances, such as “God exists,” are treated as gestures of a certain kind then this seems not to be treating them as literal statements. Many religious believers, including Wittgensteinian ones, would object strongly to this. There is room, though, for a good deal of sophisticated disagreement about what it means to take a statement literally. For instance, Charles Taylor’s view, roughly, is that the real is whatever will not go away. If we cannot reduce talk about God to anything else, or replace it, or prove it false, then perhaps God is as real as anything else.

4. Conception of Philosophy

Wittgenstein’s view of what philosophy is, or should be, changed little over his life. In the Tractatus he says at 4.111 that “philosophy is not one of the natural sciences,” and at 4.112 “Philosophy aims at the logical clarification of thoughts.” Philosophy is not descriptive but elucidatory. Its aim is to clear up muddle and confusion. It follows that philosophers should not concern themselves so much with what is actual, keeping up with the latest popularizations of science, say, which Wittgenstein despised. The philosopher’s proper concern is with what is possible, or rather with what is conceivable. This depends on our concepts and the ways they fit together as seen in language. What is conceivable and what is not, what makes sense and what does not, depends on the rules of language, of grammar.

In Philosophical Investigations Sect. 90 Wittgenstein says:

Our investigation is a grammatical one. Such an investigation sheds light on our problem by clearing misunderstandings away. Misunderstandings concerning the use of words, caused, among other things, by certain analogies between the forms of expression in different regions of language.

The similarities between the sentences “I’ll keep it in mind” and “I’ll keep it in this box,” for instance, (along with many others) can lead one to think of the mind as a thing something like a box with contents of its own. The nature of this box and its mental contents can then seem very mysterious. Wittgenstein suggests that one way, at least, to deal with such mysteries is to recall the different things one says about minds, memories, thoughts and so on, in a variety of contexts.

What one says, or what people in general say, can change. Ways of life and uses of language change, so meanings change, but not utterly and instantaneously. Things shift and evolve, but rarely if ever so drastically that we lose all grip on meaning. So there is no timeless essence of at least some and perhaps all concepts, but we still understand one another well enough most of the time.

When nonsense is spoken or written, or when something just seems fishy, we can sniff it out. The road out of confusion can be a long and difficult one, hence the need for constant attention to detail and particular examples rather than generalizations, which tend to be vague and therefore potentially misleading. The slower the route, the surer the safety at the end of it. That is why Wittgenstein said that in philosophy the winner is the one who finishes last. But we cannot escape language or the confusions to which it gives rise, except by dying. In the meantime, Wittgenstein offers four main methods to avoid philosophical confusion, as described by Norman Malcolm: describing circumstances in which a seemingly problematic expression might actually be used in everyday life, comparing our use of words with imaginary language games, imagining fictitious natural history, and explaining psychologically the temptation to use a certain expression inappropriately.

The complex, intertwined relationship between a language and the form of life that goes with it means that problems arising from language cannot just be set aside–they infect our lives, making us live in confusion. We might find our way back to the right path, but there is no guarantee that we will never again stray. In this sense there can be no progress in philosophy.

In 1931 Wittgenstein described his task thus:

Language sets everyone the same traps; it is an immense network of easily accessible wrong turnings. And so we watch one man after another walking down the same paths and we know in advance where he will branch off, where walk straight on without noticing the side turning, etc. etc. What I have to do then is erect signposts at all the junctions where there are wrong turnings so as to help people past the danger points.

But such signposts are all that philosophy can offer and there is no certainty that they will be noticed or followed correctly. And we should remember that a signpost belongs in the context of a particular problem area. It might be no help at all elsewhere, and should not be treated as dogma. So philosophy offers no truths, no theories, nothing exciting, but mainly reminders of what we all know. This is not a glamorous role, but it is difficult and important. It requires an almost infinite capacity for taking pains (which is one definition of genius) and could have enormous implications for anyone who is drawn to philosophical contemplation or who is misled by bad philosophical theories. This applies not only to professional philosophers but to any people who stray into philosophical confusion, perhaps not even realizing that their problems are philosophical and not, say, scientific.

5. Meaning

Sect. 43 of Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations says that: “For a large class of cases–though not for all–in which we employ the word “meaning” it can be defined thus: the meaning of a word is its use in the language.”

It is quite clear that here Wittgenstein is not offering the general theory that “meaning is use,” as he is sometimes interpreted as doing. The main rival views that Wittgenstein warns against are that the meaning of a word is some object that it names–in which case the meaning of a word could be destroyed, stolen or locked away, which is nonsense–and that the meaning of a word is some psychological feeling–in which case each user of a word could mean something different by it, having a different feeling, and communication would be difficult if not impossible.

Knowing the meaning of a word can involve knowing many things: to what objects the word refers (if any), whether it is slang or not, what part of speech it is, whether it carries overtones, and if so what kind they are, and so on. To know all this, or to know enough to get by, is to know the use. And generally knowing the use means knowing the meaning. Philosophical questions about consciousness, for example, then, should be responded to by looking at the various uses we make of the word “consciousness.” Scientific investigations into the brain are not directly relevant to this inquiry (although they might be indirectly relevant if scientific discoveries led us to change our use of such words). The meaning of any word is a matter of what we do with our language, not something hidden inside anyone’s mind or brain. This is not an attack on neuroscience. It is merely distinguishing philosophy (which is properly concerned with linguistic or conceptual analysis) from science (which is concerned with discovering facts).

One exception to the meaning-is-use rule of thumb is given in Philosophical Investigations Sect.561, where Wittgenstein says that “the word “is” is used with two different meanings (as the copula and as the sign of equality)” but that its meaning is not its use. That is to say, “is” has not one complex use (including both “Water is clear” and “Water is H2O”) and therefore one complex meaning, but two quite distinct uses and meanings. It is an accident that the same word has these two uses. It is not an accident that we use the word “car” to refer to both Fords and Hondas. But what is accidental and what is essential to a concept depends on us, on how we use it.

This is not completely arbitrary, however. Depending on one’s environment, one’s physical needs and desires, one’s emotions, one’s sensory capacities, and so on, different concepts will be more natural or useful to one. This is why “forms of life” are so important to Wittgenstein. What matters to you depends on how you live (and vice versa), and this shapes your experience. So if a lion could speak, Wittgenstein says, we would not be able to understand it. We might realize that “roar” meant zebra, or that “roar, roar” meant lame zebra, but we would not understand lion ethics, politics, aesthetic taste, religion, humor and such like, if lions have these things. We could not honestly say “I know what you mean” to a lion. Understanding another involves empathy, which requires the kind of similarity that we just do not have with lions, and that many people do not have with other human beings.

When a person says something what he or she means depends not only on what is said but also on the context in which it is said. Importance, point, meaning are given by the surroundings. Words, gestures, expressions come alive, as it were, only within a language game, a culture, a form of life. If a picture, say, means something then it means so to somebody. Its meaning is not an objective property of the picture in the way that its size and shape are. The same goes of any mental picture. Hence Wittgenstein’s remark that “If God had looked into our minds he would not have been able to see there whom we were speaking of.” Any internal image would need interpretation. If I interpret my thought as one of Hitler and God sees it as Charlie Chaplin, who is right? Which of the two famous contemporaries of Wittgenstein’s I mean shows itself in the way I behave, the things I do and say. It is in this that the use, the meaning, of my thought or mental picture lies. “The arrow points only in the application that a living being makes of it.”

6. Rules and Private Language

Without sharing certain attitudes towards the things around us, without sharing a sense of relevance and responding in similar ways, communication would be impossible. It is important, for instance, that nearly all of us agree nearly all the time on what colors things are. Such agreement is part of our concept of color, Wittgenstein suggests. Regularity of the use of such concepts and agreement in their application is part of language, not a logically necessary precondition of it. We cannot separate the life in which there is such agreement from our concept of color. Imagine a different form or way of life and you imagine a different language with different concepts, different rules and a different logic.

This raises the question of the relation between language and forms or ways of life. For instance, could just one person have a language of his or her own? To imagine an individual solitary from birth is scarcely to imagine a form of life at all, but more like just imagining a life- form. Moreover, language involves rules establishing certain linguistic practices. Rules of grammar express the fact that it is our practice to say this (e.g. “half past twelve”) and not that (e.g. “half to one”). Agreement is essential to such practices. Could a solitary individual, then, engage in any practice, including linguistic ones? With whom could he or she agree? This is a controversial issue in the interpretation of Wittgenstein. Gordon Baker and P.M.S. Hacker hold that such a solitary man could speak his own language, follow his own rules, and so on, agreeing, over time, with himself in his judgements and behavior. Orthodoxy is against this interpretation, however.

Norman Malcolm has written that “If you conceive of an individual who has been in solitude his whole life long, then you have cut away the background of instruction, correction, acceptance–in short, the circumstances in which a rule is given, enforced, and followed.” Mere regularity of behavior does not constitute following rules, whether they be rules of grammar or any other kind. A car that never starts in cold weather does not follow the rule “Don’t start when it’s cold,” nor does a songbird follow a rule in singing the same song every day. Whether a solitary-from-birth individual would ever do anything that we would properly call following a rule is at least highly doubtful. How could he or she give himself or herself a rule to follow without language? And how could he or she get a language? Inventing one would involve inventing meaning, as Rush Rhees has argued, and this sounds incoherent. (The most famous debate about this was between Rhees and A.J. Ayer. Unfortunately for Wittgenstein, Ayer is generally considered to have won.) Alternatively, perhaps the Crusoe-like figure just does behave, sound, etc. just like a native speaker of, say, English. But this is to imagine either a freakish automaton, not a human being, or else a miracle. In the case of a miracle, Wittgenstein says, it is significant that we imagine not just the pseudo- Crusoe but also God. In the case of the automatic speaker, we might adopt what Daniel Dennett calls an “intentional stance” towards him, calling what he does “speaking English,” but he is obviously not doing what the rest of us English-speakers–who learned the language, rather than being born speaking it, and who influence and are influenced by others in our use of the language–do.

The debate about solitary individuals is sometimes referred to as the debate about “private language.” Wittgenstein uses this expression in another context, however, to name a language that refers to private sensations. Such a private language by definition cannot be understood by anyone other than its user (who alone knows the sensations to which it refers). Wittgenstein invites us to imagine a man who decides to write ‘S’ in his diary whenever he has a certain sensation. This sensation has no natural expression, and ‘S’ cannot be defined in words. The only judge of whether ‘S’ is used correctly is the inventor of ‘S’. The only criterion of correctness is whether a sensation feels the same to him or her. There are no criteria for its being the same other than its seeming the same. So he writes ‘S’ when he feels like it. He might as well be doodling. The so-called ‘private language’ is no language at all. The point of this is not to show that a private language is impossible but to show that certain things one might want to say about language are ultimately incoherent. If we really try to picture a world of private objects (sensations) and inner acts of meaning and so on, we see that what we picture is either regular public language or incomprehensible behavior (the man might as well quack as say or write ‘S’).

This does not, as has been alleged, make Wittgenstein a behaviorist. He does not deny the existence of sensations or experiences. Pains, tickles, itches, etc. are all part of human life, of course. At Philosophical Investigations Sect. 293 Wittgenstein says that “if we construe the grammar of the expression of sensation on the model of ‘object and designation’ the object drops out of consideration as irrelevant.” This suggests not that pains and so on are irrelevant but that we should not construe the grammar of the expression of sensation on the model of ‘object and designation’. If we want to understand a concept like pain we should not think of a pain as a private object referred to somehow by the public word “pain.” A pain is not “a something,” just as love, democracy and strength are not things, but it is no more “a nothing” than they are either (see Philosophical Investigations Sect. 304). Saying this is hardly satisfactory, but there is no simple answer to the question “What is pain?” Wittgenstein offers not an answer but a kind of philosophical ‘therapy’ intended to clear away what can seem so obscure. To judge the value of this therapy, the reader will just have to read Wittgenstein’s work for herself.

The best known work on Wittgenstein’s writings on this whole topic is Saul A. Kripke’s Wittgenstein on Rules and Private Language. Kripke is struck by the idea that anything might count as continuing a series or following a rule in the same way. It all depends on how the rule or series is interpreted. And any rule for interpretation will itself be subject to a variety of interpretations, and so on. What counts as following a rule correctly, then, is not determined somehow by the rule itself but by what the relevant linguistic community accepts as following the rule. So whether two plus two equals four depends not on some abstract, extra-human rule of addition, but on what we, and especially the people we appoint as experts, accept. Truth conditions are replaced by assertability conditions. To put it crudely, what counts is not what is true or right (in some sense independent of the community of language users), but what you can get away with or get others to accept.

Kripke’s theory is clear and ingenious, and owes a lot to Wittgenstein, but is doubtful as an interpretation of Wittgenstein. Kripke himself presents the argument not as Wittgenstein’s, nor as his own, but as “Wittgenstein’s argument as it struck Kripke” (Kripke p.5). That the argument is not Wittgenstein’s is suggested by the fact that it is a theory, and Wittgenstein rejected philosophical theories, and by the fact that the argument relies heavily on the first sentence of Philosophical Investigations Sect. 201: “This was our paradox: no course of action could be determined by a rule, because every course of action can be made out to accord with the rule.” For Kripke’s theory as a reading of Wittgenstein, it is not good that the very next paragraph begins, “It can be seen that there is a misunderstanding here…” Still, it is no easy matter to see just where Wittgenstein does diverge from the hybrid person often referred to as ‘Kripkenstein’. The key perhaps lies later in the same paragraph, where Wittgenstein writes that “there is a way of grasping a rule which is not an interpretation“. Many scholars, notably Baker and Hacker, have gone to great lengths to explain why Kripke is mistaken. Since Kripke is so much easier to understand, one of the best ways into Wittgenstein’s philosophy is to study Kripke and his Wittgensteinian critics. At the very least, Kripke introduces his readers well to issues that were of great concern to Wittgenstein and shows their importance.

7. Realism and Anti-Realism

Wittgenstein’s place in the debate about philosophical Realism and Anti-Realism is an interesting one. His emphasis on language and human behavior, practices, etc. makes him a prime candidate for Anti-Realism in many people’s eyes. He has even been accused of linguistic idealism, the idea that language is the ultimate reality. The laws of physics, say, would by this theory just be laws of language, the rules of the language game of physics. Anti-Realist scepticism of this kind has proved quite popular in the philosophy of science and in theology, as well as more generally in metaphysics and ethics.

On the other hand, there is a school of Wittgensteinian Realism, which is less well known. Wittgenstein’s views on religion, for instance, are often compared with those of Simone Weil, who was a Platonist of sorts. Sabina Lovibond argues for a kind of Wittgensteinian Realism in ethics in her Realism and Imagination in Ethics and the influence of Wittgenstein is clear in Raimond Gaita’s Good and Evil: An Absolute Conception. However, one should not go too far with the idea of Wittgensteinian Realism. Lovibond, for instance, equates objectivity with intersubjectivity (universal agreement), so her Realism is of a controversial kind.

Both Realism and Anti-Realism, though, are theories, or schools of theories, and Wittgenstein explicitly rejects the advocacy of theories in philosophy. This does not prove that he practiced what he preached, but it should give us pause. It is also worth noting that supporters of Wittgenstein often claim that he was neither a Realist nor an Anti-Realist, at least with regard to metaphysics. There is something straightforwardly unWittgensteinian about the Realist’s belief that language/thought can be compared with reality and found to ‘agree’ with it. The Anti-Realist says that we could not get outside our thought or language (or form of life or language games) to compare the two. But Wittgenstein was concerned not with what we can or cannot do, but with what makes sense. If metaphysical Realism is incoherent then so is its opposite. The nonsensical utterance “laubgefraub” is not to be contradicted by saying, “No, it is not the case that laubgefraub,” or “Laubgefraub is a logical impossibility.” If Realism is truly incoherent, as Wittgenstein would say, then so is Anti-Realism.

8. Certainty

Wittgenstein’s last writings were on the subject of certainty. He wrote in response to G.E. Moore’s attack on scepticism about the external world. Moore had held up one hand, said “Here is one hand,” then held up his other hand and said “and here is another.” His point was that things outside the mind really do exist, we know they do, and that no grounds for scepticism could be strong enough to undermine this commonsense knowledge.

Wittgenstein did not defend scepticism, but questioned Moore’s claim to know that he had two hands. Such ‘knowledge’ is not something that one is ever taught, or finds out, or proves. It is more like a background against which we come to know other things. Wittgenstein compares this background to the bed of a river. This river bed provides the support, the context, in which claims to know various things have meaning. The bed itself is not something we can know or doubt. In normal circumstances no sane person doubts how many hands he or she has. But unusual circumstances can occur and what was part of the river bed can shift and become part of the river. I might, for instance, wake up dazed after a terrible accident and wonder whether my hands, which I cannot feel, are still there or not. This is quite different, though, from Descartes’s pretended doubt as to whether he has a body at all. Such radical doubt is really not doubt at all, from Wittgenstein’s point of view. And so it cannot be dispelled by a proof that the body exists, as Moore tried to do.

9. Continuity

Wittgenstein is generally considered to have changed his thinking considerably over his philosophical career. His early work culminated in the Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus with its picture theory of language and mysticism, according to this view. Then there came a transitional middle period when he first returned to philosophical work after realizing that he had not solved all the problems of philosophy. This period led to his mature, later period which gave us the Philosophical Investigations and On Certainty.

There certainly are marked changes in Wittgenstein’s work, but the differences between his early and late work can be exaggerated. Two central discontinuities in his work are these: whereas the Tractatus is concerned with the general form of the proposition, the general nature of metaphysics, and so on, in his later work Wittgenstein is very critical of “the craving for generality”; and, in the Tractatus Wittgenstein speaks of the central problems of philosophy, whereas the later work treats no problems as central. Another obvious difference is in Wittgenstein’s style. The Tractatus is a carefully constructed set of short propositions. The Investigations, though also consisting of numbered sections, is longer, less clearly organized and more rambling, at least in appearance. This reflects Wittgenstein’s rejection of the idea that there are just a few central problems in philosophy, and his insistence on paying attention to particular cases, going over the rough ground.

On the other hand, the Tractatus itself says that its propositions are nonsense and thus, in a sense (not easy to understand), rejects itself. The fact that the later work also criticizes the Tractatus is not, therefore, proof of discontinuity in Wittgenstein’s work. The main change may have been one of method and style. Problems are investigated one at a time, although many overlap. There is not a full-frontal assault on the problem or problems of philosophy. Otherwise, the Tractatus and the Philosophical Investigations attack much the same problems; they just do so in different ways.

10. Wittgenstein in History

Wittgenstein’s place in the history of philosophy is a peculiar one. His philosophical education was unconventional (going from engineering to working first-hand with one of the greatest philosophers of his day in Bertrand Russell) and he seems never to have felt the need to go back and make a thorough study of the history of philosophy. He was interested in Plato, admired Leibniz, but was most influenced by the work of Schopenhauer, Russell and Frege.

From Schopenhauer (perhaps) Wittgenstein got his interest in solipsism and in the ethical nature of the relation between the will and the world. Schopenhauer’s saying that “The world is my idea,” (from The World as Will and Idea) is echoed in such remarks as “The world is my world” (from Tractatus 5.62). What Wittgenstein means here, where he also says that what the solipsist means is quite correct, but that it cannot be said, is obscure and controversial. Some have taken him to mean that solipsism is true but for some reason cannot be expressed. H.O. Mounce, in his valuable Wittgenstein’s Tractatus: An Introduction, says that this interpretation is surely wrong. Mounce’s view is that Wittgenstein holds solipsism itself to be a confusion, but one that sometimes arises when one tries to express the fact that “I have a point of view on the world which is without neighbours.” (Mounce p.91) Wittgenstein was not a solipsist but he remained interested in solipsism and related problems of scepticism throughout his life.

Frege was a mathematician as well as a logician. He was interested in questions of truth and falsehood, sense and reference (a distinction he made famous) and in the relation between objects and concepts, propositions and thoughts. But his interest was in logic and mathematics exclusively, not in psychology or ethics. His great contribution to logic was to introduce various mathematical elements into formal logic, including quantification, functions, arguments (in the mathematical sense of something substituted for a variable in a function) and the value of a function. In logic this value, according to Frege, is always either the True or the False, hence the notion of truth-value. Both Frege and Russell wanted to show that mathematics is an extension of logic. Undoubtedly both men influenced Wittgenstein enormously, especially since he worked first-hand with Russell. Some measure of their importance to him can be seen in the preface to the Tractatus, where Wittgenstein says that he is “indebted to Frege’s great works and to the writings of my friend Mr Bertrand Russell for much of the stimulation of my thoughts.” For some insight into whether Frege or Russell had the greater influence one can consider whether one would rather be recognized for his or her great works or for simply being a friend.

In turn Wittgenstein influenced twentieth century philosophy enormously. The Vienna Circle logical positivists were greatly impressed by what they found in the Tractatus, especially the idea that logic and mathematics are analytic, the verifiability principle and the idea that philosophy is an activity aimed at clarification, not the discovery of facts. Wittgenstein, though, said that it was what is not in the Tractatus that matters most.

The other group of philosophers most obviously indebted to Wittgenstein is the ordinary language or Oxford school of thought. These thinkers were more interested in Wittgenstein’s later work and its attention to grammar.

Wittgenstein is thus a doubly key figure in the development and history of analytic philosophy, but he has become rather unfashionable because of his anti-theoretical, anti-scientism stance, because of the difficulty of his work, and perhaps also because he has been little understood. Similarities between Wittgenstein’s work and that of Derrida are now generating interest among continental philosophers, and Wittgenstein may yet prove to be a driving force behind the emerging post-analytic school of philosophy.

11. References and Further Reading

A full bibliographical guide to works by and on Wittgenstein would fill a whole book, namely Wittgenstein: A Bibliographical Guide by Guido Frongia and Brian McGuinness (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1990). Obviously this is already out of date. Instead of a complete guide, therefore, what follows is a list of some of Wittgenstein’s main works, some of the best secondary material on his work, and a few other works chosen for their accessibility and entertainment value, for want of a better expression.

a. Wittgenstein’s Main Works

Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, translated by D.F. Pears and B.F. McGuinness (Routledge and Kegan Paul, London 1961).
- His early classic.
The Blue and Brown Books, (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1969).
- From his middle period, these are preliminary studies for his later work.
Philosophical Investigations, translated by G.E.M. Anscombe (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1963).
- His late classic.
On Certainty, edited by G.E.M. Anscombe and G.H. von Wright, translated by Denis Paul and G.E.M. Anscombe (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1979).
- Like many of Wittgenstein’s works, this was compiled after his death from notes he had made. In this case the notes come from the last year and a half of his life.Works of more general interest by Wittgenstein include these:
Culture and Value, translated by Peter Winch (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1980).
- These are notes from throughout Wittgenstein’s life dealing with all kinds of topics hinted at by its title, including music, literature, philosophy, religion and the value of silliness.
Lectures and Conversations on Aesthetics, Psychology and Religious Belief, edited by Cyril Barrett (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1966).
- For ‘psychology’ read ‘Freud’, otherwise the title is explanation enough. Hilary Putnam has recommended the section on religion as a valuable introduction to Wittgenstein’s philosophy as a whole.

b. Some Biographies of Wittgenstein

Ray Monk Ludwig Wittgenstein: The Duty of Genius (Jonathan Cape, London 1990).
- Full of enlightening detail.
Norman Malcolm Ludwig Wittgenstein: A Memoir (Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York 1984).
- Shorter and includes material from G.H. von Wright as well. Two of the best books on the Tractatus are:
G.E.M. Anscombe An Introduction to Wittgenstein’s Tractatus (University of Pennsylvania Press, Philadelphia 1971).
- Emphasizes the importance of Frege and is notoriously difficult
H.O. Mounce Wittgenstein’s Tractatus: An Introduction (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1981).
- Lighter but more reader-friendly.

c. Secondary Works

A good rule of thumb for picking secondary material on Wittgenstein is to trust Wittgenstein’s own judgement. He chose G.E.M. Anscombe, Rush Rhees and G.H. von Wright to understand and deal with his unpublished writings after his death. Anything by one of these people should be fairly reliable. More contentiously, I would say that the best people writing on Wittgenstein today are James Conant and Cora Diamond. Other books referred to in the text above or of special note are these:

O.K. Bouwsma Wittgenstein: Conversations 1949-1951, edited by J.L. Craft and Ronald E. Hustwit (Hackett, Indianapolis 1986).
- A seemingly little read slim volume that includes records of Wittgenstein’s comments on such diverse and interesting topics as Descartes, utilitarianism and the word ‘cheeseburger’.
Stanley Cavell The Claim of Reason: Wittgenstein, Skepticism, Morality, and Tragedy (Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York 1979).
- A long, rich, challenging classic.
Cora Diamond The Realistic Spirit: Wittgenstein, Philosophy, and the Mind (MIT, Cambridge, Massachusetts 1991).
- A collection of essays of varying degrees of accessibility on Frege, Wittgenstein and ethics, united by their Wittgensteinian spirit.
M.O’C. Drury The Danger of Words (Thoemmes Press, Bristol, U.K. and Washington, D.C. 1996).
- A classic, including discussions of issues in psychiatry and religion by a friend of Wittgenstein’s.
Paul Engelmann Letters from Wittgenstein with a memoir (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1967).
- Includes discussions by Wittgenstein and his friend Engelmann on the Tractatus, religion, literature and culture.
Saul A. Kripke Wittgenstein on Rules and Private Language (Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Massachusetts 1982).
- See the section on rules and private language above.
Norman Malcolm Wittgenstein: Nothing is Hidden (Basil Blackwell, Oxford 1986).
- One of the best accounts of Wittgenstein’s philosophy from the disreputable point of view that the Tractatus advanced theses which are then attacked in the later work.
Norman Malcolm Wittgenstein: A Religious Point of View?, edited with a response by Peter Winch (Cornell University Press, Ithaca, New York 1994).
- Malcolm basically summarizes Wittgenstein’s philosophy, as he understands it, with a special emphasis on religion. Winch then responds, correcting Malcolm’s account where necessary. The result is a highly accessible composite overview of Wittgenstein’s work from the religious point of view, which is how Wittgenstein himself said that he saw every problem.

Author Information

Duncan J. Richter
Email: RICHTERDJ@vmi.edu
Virginia Military Institute
U. S. A.

Xunzi (Hsün Tzu, c. 310—c. 220 B.C.E.)

xunzi Xunzi, along with Confucius and Mencius, was one of the three great early architects of Confucian philosophy. In many ways, he offers a more complete and sophisticated defense of Confucianism than Mencius. Xunzi lived toward the end of the Warring States period (453-221 BCE), generally regarded as the formative era for most later Chinese philosophy. It was a time of great variety of thought, comparable to classical Greece, so Xunzi was acquainted with many competing ideas. In reaction to some of the other thinkers of the time, he articulated a systematic version of Confucianism that encompasses ethics, metaphysics, political theory, philosophy of language, and a highly developed philosophy of education. Xunzi is known for his belief that ritual is crucial for reforming humanity’s original nature. Human nature lacks an innate moral compass, and left to itself falls into contention and disorder, which is why Xunzi characterizes human nature as bad. Ritual is thus an integral part of a stable society. He focused on humanity’s part in creating the roles and practices of an orderly society, and gave a much smaller role to Heaven or Nature as a source of order or morality than most other thinkers of the time. Although his thought was later considered to be outside of Confucian orthodoxy, it was still very influential in China and remains a source of interest today. (See Romanization systems for Chinese terms.)

Life and Work
The Way and Heaven
Human Nature, Education, and the Ethical Ideal
Logic and Language
Social and Political Thought
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Xunzi (“Master Xun”) is the common appellation for the philosopher whose full name was Xun Kuang. He is also known as Xun Qing, “Minister Xun,” after an office he held. He was born in the state of Zhao in north-central China around 310 BCE. As a young man he studied in the state of Qi in the northeast, which had the greatest concentration of philosophers of the age. Xunzi’s writings show him to be well acquainted with all the doctrines current at the time, which he probably came in contact with during this period of his life. Leaving Qi, he traveled to many of the other states that made up China at the time, and was briefly employed by some of them. His last post ended when his patron was assassinated in 238 BCE, ending his chances to put his theories of government into practice. Xunzi may have lived to see China unified by the authoritarian state of Qin in 221 BCE. If so, he certainly must have been disappointed that two of his former students, Li Si and Han Feizi, helped counsel Qin to victory when the Qin government was steadfastly opposed to Xunzi’s ideas of government through moral power. The Qin dynasty was long remembered as a time of strict laws and draconian punishments, and Xunzi’s association with two of its architects probably was one factor in the later marginalization of his thought.

Like most philosophical works of the time, the Xunzi that we have today is a later compilation of writings associated with him, not all of which were necessarily written by Xunzi himself. The current version of the Xunzi is divided into thirty-two books, about twenty-five of which are considered mostly or wholly authentic and others of which are considered representative of his thought, if not his actual writings. This is probably the largest collection of early Chinese philosophical writings that can be plausibly attributed to one author. The Xunzi is also notable for its style. Comparatively little of it is written in the dialogue format of works like the Mencius, and there are none of the fanciful parables of the Zhuangzi. Most books normally attributed to Xunzi are sustained essays on one topic that appear to have be written as more or less unified pieces, though there are often sections of verse and two books that are merely compilations of poetry. In these writings, Xunzi carefully defines his own position and raises objections to rival thinkers in a way that renders his work more recognizable as philosophy than that of many other early Chinese thinkers.

2. The Way and Heaven

The most important concept in Xunzi’s philosophy is the Way (dao). This is one of the most common terms of Chinese philosophy, though all thinkers define it somewhat differently. Though the term originally referred to a road or path, it became extended to a way of doing things, a way of acting, or as it was used in philosophy, the right way to live. In Xunzi’s case, he means the human way, the way of good government and the proper way of behaving, not the Way of Heaven or Nature as Laozi and Zhuangzi define it, and as Mencius often suggests. In fact, Xunzi is notable for having probably the most rationalistic view of Heaven and the supernatural in the early period. Xunzi claims that the Way was first pointed out by particularly wise and gifted people he calls sages (a common term for an exemplar in early Chinese thought), and following the Way as it has been handed down from the past will result in a stable, prosperous, peaceful society, while going against it will have the opposite results. While certain aspects of the Way, such as particular rituals, are certainly created by humanity, whether the Way as a whole is created or discovered remains a matter of scholarly debate.

Unlike many other early philosophers, Xunzi does not believe Heaven gets involved in human affairs. Heaven was sometimes considered to be an anthropomorphic god, sometimes an impersonal force that automatically rewarded the good and punished the bad, but in Xunzi’s view Heaven is much like Nature: it acts as it always does, neither helping the good or harming the bad. The Way is not the Way because Heaven approves of it, it is the Way because it is good for people. In the chapter “Discourse on Heaven” (chapter 17, also translated as “Discourse on Nature”), Xunzi devotes himself to refuting these other views of Heaven, most prominently that of the Mohists. Heaven does not reward good kings with peace and prosperity, nor punish tyrants by having them deposed. These results come about through their own good or bad decisions. Having a good harvest and sufficient food is not a sign of Heaven’s favor, it is the result of wise agricultural policy. Similarly, events like eclipses and floods are not signs of Heaven’s displeasure: they are simply things that sometimes happen. One might wonder at them as unusual occurrences, but it is not right to be afraid of them or consider them ominous. Worrying about Heaven’s favor is a waste of time; it is better to be prepared for whatever might happen. There will be some natural disasters, but if one is prepared they will not cause harm.

Interestingly, though Xunzi has this rational view of Nature, which extends to spirits and gods as well, he never suggests eliminating religious rituals that are directed toward them, such as sacrifices and divination. One must perform them as part of the ritual system that binds society together, but one does not perform expecting any results. In “Discourse on Heaven,” Xunzi wrote, “You pray for rain and it rains. Why? For no particular reason, I say. It is just as though you had not prayed for rain and it rained anyway.” When it rains after you pray for rain, it is just like when it rains when you didn’t pray for it. Yet during a drought, officials must still pray for rain—not because it has any effect on the natural world, but because of its effect on people. What Xunzi believes ritual does will be examined later.

In Xunzi’s view, the best thing to do is understand what Nature does and what humanity does, and concentrate on the latter. Not only is it wrong to believe that Heaven intervenes in human affairs, it is useless to speculate about why Nature is the way it is or to try to help it along. Xunzi is interested in practical knowledge, and speculation about Nature is not useful. In this respect, he could be considered anti-metaphysical, since he has no interest in how the world works or what it is. His concern is what people should do, and anything that might confuse or detract from that is a waste of time. We know that Nature is invariable, and we know the Way to get what we need from Nature to live, and that is all we need to know. This kind of division between knowledge of the human world and knowledge of Heaven may have been partially influenced by Zhuangzi, but while Zhuangzi considers knowing Heaven to be important, Xunzi does not.

3. Human Nature, Education, and the Ethical Ideal

a. Human Nature

As Mencius is known for the slogan “human nature is good,” Xunzi is known for its opposite, “human nature is bad.” Mencius viewed self-cultivation as developing natural tendencies within us. Xunzi believes that our natural tendencies lead to conflict and disorder, and what we need to do is radically reform them, not develop them. Both shared an optimism about human perfectability, but they viewed the process quite differently. Xunzi envisioned that humanity was once in a state of nature reminiscent of Hobbes. Without study of the Way, people’s desires will run rampant, and they will inevitably find themselves in conflict in trying to satisfy their desires. Left to themselves, people will fall into disorder, poverty and conflict, living a life that would be, as Hobbes put it, “poor, nasty, brutish, and short.” It was this insistence that human nature is bad that was most often condemned by later thinkers, who rejected Xunzi’s view in favor of the idea, traced to Mencius, that people are naturally good.

Xunzi offers several arguments against Mencius’s position. He defines human nature as what is inborn and does not need to be learned. He argues that if people were good by nature, there would be no need for ritual and social norms. The sages would not have had to create them, and they would not need to have been handed down through the generations. They were created precisely because people do not act in accordance with them naturally. He also notes that people desire the good, and on the principle that one desires what one doesn’t already have, this shows that people are not good. He gives several illustrations of what life is like in the state of nature, without any education on ritual and morality. Xunzi does not believe that people are evil, that they deliberately violate the rules of morality, taking a perverse pleasure in doing so. They have no natural conception of morality at all: they are morally blind by nature. Their desires bring them into conflict because they don’t know any better, not because they enjoy conflict. In fact, Xunzi believes people do not enjoy it at all, which is why they desire the kind of life that results from good order brought about through the rituals of the sages.

Like Mencius, Xunzi believed human nature is the same in everyone: no one starts off with moral principles. The original nature of Yao (a legendary sage king) and Jie (a legendary tyrant) was the same. The difference was in how they cultivated themselves. Yao reformed his original nature, Jie did not. In this way, Xunzi emphasizes the essential perfectability of everyone. Human nature is bad, but it is not incorrigible, and in fact Xunzi was rather optimistic about the possibility of overcoming the demands of desires that result in the state of nature. Though Confucius suggests that some people are better off by nature than others, Mencius and Xunzi seem to agree that everyone starts out the same, though they differ on the content of that original state. Though Xunzi believes that it is always possible to reform oneself, he recognizes that in reality this will not always happen. In most cases, the individual himself has to make the first step in attempting to reform, and Xunzi is rather pessimistic about people actually doing this. They cannot be forced to do so, and they may in practice be unable to make the choice to improve, but for Xunzi, this does not mean that in principle it is impossible for them to change.

b. Education

Like Confucius and Mencius, Xunzi is much more concerned with what kind of person to be than with rules of moral behavior or duty, and in this respect his view is similar to Western virtue ethics. The goal of Xunzi’s ethics is to become a person who knows and acts according to the Way as if it were second nature. Because human nature is bad, Xunzi emphasizes the importance of study to learn the Way. He compares the process of reforming one’s nature to making a pot out of clay or straightening wood with a press-frame. Without the potter, the clay would never become a pot on its own. Similarly, people will not be able to reform their nature without a teacher showing them what to do. Xunzi’s concern is primarily moral education; he wants people to develop into good people, not people who know a lot of facts. He emphasizes the transformative aspect of education, where it changes one’s basic nature. Xunzi laid out a program of study based on the works of the sages of the past that would teach proper ritual behavior and develop moral principles. He was the first to offer an organized Confucian curriculum, and his curriculum became the blueprint for traditional education in China until the modern period.

Practice was an important aspect of Xunzi’s course of education. A student did not simply study ritual, he performed it. Xunzi recognized that this performative aspect was crucial to the goal of transforming one’s nature. It was only through practice that one could realize the beauty of ritual, ideally coming to appreciate it for itself. Though this was the end of education, Xunzi appealed to more utilitarian motives to start the student on the program of study. As noted above, he discussed how desires would inevitably be frustrated in the state of nature. Organizing society through ritual was the only way people could ever satisfy even some of their desires, and study of ritual was the best way to achieve satisfaction on a personal level. Through study and practice, one could learn to appreciate ritual for its own sake, not just as a means to satisfy desires. Ritual has this power to transform someone’s motives and character. The beginning student of ritual is like a child learning to play the piano. Maybe she doesn’t enjoy playing the piano at first, but her parents take her out for ice cream after each lesson, so she goes along with it because she gets what she wants. After years of study and practice, she might learn to appreciate playing the piano for its own sake, and will practice even without any reward. This is what Xunzi imagines will happen to the dedicated student of ritual: he starts out studying ritual as a means, but it becomes an end in itself as part of the Way.

c. The Ethical Ideal

Xunzi often distinguishes three stages of progress in study: the scholar, the gentlemen, and the sage, though sometimes the sage and the gentleman seem to be equivalent for him. These were all terms in common use in philosophical discourse of the time, especially in Confucian thought, but Xunzi gives them a unique twist. He describes the achievements of each stage slightly differently in several places, but what he seems to mean is that a scholar is someone who has taken the first step of wishing to study the Way of the ancient sages and adopts them as the model for correct conduct; the gentleman has acquired a good deal of learning, but still must think about what the right thing to do is in a situation; and the sage has wholly internalized the principles of ritual and morality so that his action flows spontaneously without the need for thought, yet never goes beyond the bounds of what is proper. Using the piano analogy, the scholar has made up his mind to study the piano and is practicing basic scales. The gentleman is fairly skilled, but still needs to look at the music in front of him to know what to play. The sage is like a concert pianist who not only plays with perfect technique, but also adds his own style and unique interpretation of the music, accomplishing all this without ever consciously thinking about what notes to play. As the pianist is still playing someone else’s music, the sage does not make up new standards of conduct; he still follows the Way, but he makes it his own. Yet even then, at this highest stage, Xunzi believes there is still room for learning. Study is a lifelong process that only ends at death, much as concert pianists must still practice to maintain their skills.

The teacher plays an extremely important role in the course of study. A good teacher does not simply know the rituals, he embodies them and practices them in his own life. Just as one would not learn piano from someone who had just read a book on piano pedagogy but never touched an actual instrument, one should not study from someone who has only learned texts. A teacher is not just a source of information; he is a model for the student to look up to and a source of inspiration of what to become. A teacher who does not live up to the Way of the sages in his own life is no teacher at all. Xunzi believes there is no better method of study than learning from such a teacher. In this way, the student has a model before of him of how to live ritual principles, so his learning does not become simple accumulation of facts. In the event that such a teacher is unavailable, the next best method is to honor ritual principles sincerely, trying to embody them in oneself. Without either of these methods, Xunzi believes learning degenerates into memorizing a jumble of facts with no impact on one’s conduct.

d. Discovering the Way

Given Xunzi’s insistence on the importance of teachers to transmit the Way of the sages of the past and his belief that people are all bad by nature, he must face the question of how the first sages discovered the Way. Xunzi uses the metaphor of a river ford for the true Way: without the people who have gone before to leave markers, those coming after would have no way of knowing where the deep places are, and they would be in danger of drowning. The question is, how did the first people get across safely, when there were no markers? Xunzi does not address the question in precisely this way, but we can piece together an answer from his writings.

Examining the analogies Xunzi uses is instructive here. He talks about cultivating moral principles as a process of crafting, using the metaphors of a potter shaping and firing clay into a pot, or using a press-frame to straighten a bent piece of wood. Just as the skill of making pottery was undoubtedly accumulated through generations of refining, Xunzi appears to think that the Way of the sages was also a product of generations of development. According to Xunzi’s definition of human nature, no one could say people know how to make pots by nature: this is not something we can do without study and practice, like walking and talking are. Nevertheless, some people, through a combination of perseverance, talent, and luck, were able to discover how to make pots, and then taught that skill to others. Similarly, through generations of observing humanity and trying different ways of regulating society, the sages hit upon the correct Way, the best way to order society in Xunzi’s view. David Nivison has suggested that different sages of the past contributed different aspects of the Way: some discovered agriculture, some discovered fire, some discovered the principles of filiality and respect between husband and wife, and so on.

Xunzi views these achievements as products of the sage’s acquired nature, not his original nature. This is another way of saying these are not products of people’s natural tendencies, but the results of study and experimentation. Accumulation of effort is an important concept for Xunzi. The Way of the sages was created through accumulation of learning what worked and benefited society. The sages built on the accomplishments of previous sages, added their own contributions, and now Xunzi believes the process is basically complete: we know the ritual principles that will produce a harmonious society. Trying to govern or become a moral person without studying the sages of the past is essentially trying to re-invent the wheel, or discover how to make pots on one’s own without learning from a potter. It is conceivable (though Xunzi is very skeptical about anyone actually being able to do it), but it is much more difficult and time-consuming, when all one has to do is study what has already been created.

e. The Heart

In addition to having a teacher, a critical requirement for study is having the proper frame of mind, or more precisely, heart, since early Chinese thought considered cognition to be located in the heart. Xunzi’s philosophy of the heart draws from other contemporary views as well as Confucian philosophy. Like Mencius, Xunzi believed that the heart should be the lord of the body, and using the heart to direct desires and decide on right and wrong accords with the Way. However, like Zhuangzi, Xunzi emphasizes that the heart must be tranquil and concentrated to be able to learn. In the view of the heart basically shared by Xunzi and Mencius, desires are not wholly voluntary. Desires are part of human nature, and can be activated without our necessarily being conscious of them. The function of the heart is to regulate the sense faculties and parts of the body, so that though one may have desires, the heart only acts on those desires when it is right to do so. The heart controls itself and directs the other parts of the body. This ability of the heart is what allows humanity to create ritual and moral principles and escape the state of nature.

In the chapter “Dispelling Blindness” Xunzi discusses the right way to develop the heart to avoid falling into error. For study, the heart needs to be trained to be receptive, focused, and calm. These qualities of the heart allow it to know the Way, and knowing the Way, the heart can realize the benefits of the Way and practice it. This receptivity Xunzi calls emptiness, meaning the ability of the heart to continually store new information without becoming full. Focus is called unity, by which Xunzi means the ability to be aware of two aspects of a thing or situation without allowing them to interfere with each other. “Being of two hearts” was a common problem in Chinese philosophical writings: it could mean being confused or perplexed about something, as well as what we would call being two-faced. Xunzi addresses the first aspect with his discussion of unity, a focus that keeps the heart directed and free from perplexity. The final quality the heart needs is stillness, the quality of moving freely from task to task without disorder, remaining unperturbed while processing new information. A heart that has the qualities of emptiness, unity, and stillness can understand the Way. Without these qualities, the heart is liable to fall into various kinds of “blindness” or obsessions that Xunzi attributes to his philosophical rivals. Their hearts focus too much on just one aspect of the Way, so they are unable to see the big picture. They become obsessed with this one part and mistake it for the entirety of the Way. Only with the proper attitudes and control of one’s heart can one perceive and grasp the Way as a whole.

4. Logic and Language

One subject that was certainly not part of Xunzi’s program of study is logic. Other philosophers, particularly the Mohist school, were developing sophisticated views on logic and the principles of argumentation around Xunzi’s time, and other thinkers were known for their paradoxes that played with language to show its limits. Though Xunzi was undoubtedly influenced by the principles of argument developed by the Mohists, he had no patience for the dialectical games and disputation for its own sake that were popular at the time. According to one story, a philosopher, having just convinced a king through his arguments, then took the other side and persuaded the king that his earlier arguments were wrong. Such exercises in argument and rhetoric were a waste of time for Xunzi; the only correct use of argument was to convince someone of the truth. Even the work of trying to distinguish logical categories was not productive in his view. According to Xunzi, such work can accomplish something, but it is still not the province of the gentlemen, much as wondering about the workings of nature are not the gentlemen’s concern, either. The only proper object of study is the Way of the sages; anything else is at best useless and at worst detrimental to the Way.

Despite his professed disinterest in logic, Xunzi came up with the most detailed philosophy of language in early Confucian thought. Again, however, his primary concern was preserving the Way in the face of attacks, which in Xunzi’s view included questions about the nature of language that were arising at the time. He defended a modified conventionalism concerning language: names were not intrinsically appropriate for the objects they referred to, but once usage was determined by convention, to depart from it is wrong. It would be a mistake to think of Xunzi’s view as a kind of nominalism, however, since he is very clear that there is an objective reality that names refer to. The particular phonemes used to make the word “cat” in language are conventionally determined, but the fact that a cat is a kind of feline is real. One of the fundamental principles of Confucianism was that the reality must match the name. Confucian thinkers were most concerned about the names of social roles: a father must act like a father should, a ruler must act like a ruler should. Not fulfilling the demands of one’s role means that one does not deserve the title, hence Mencius defined the removal of a tyrant as the killing of a commoner, not regicide. Xunzi defended this view, yet he objected to the Mohists, who claimed that a robber is not a person, so that killing a robber is not killing a person. This kind of usage violated the principles of correct naming and departed from the Way, though Xunzi is not entirely clear why. In Xunzi’s view, the reality represented by a name is objective, even if the name is merely conventional. Because of the objectivity of referent, he distinguishes appropriate (following convention) and inappropriate (violating convention) uses of names. In addition, he believes there are good and bad names. Good names are simple and direct and readily bring the referent to mind. Using names in a way that the referents are clear is using names correctly. The chief function of language is to communicate, and anything that interferes with communication, such as the word games and paradoxes of other philosophers, should be eliminated.

5. Social and Political Thought

a. Government structure

The Warring States period, during which Xunzi lived, was a time of great social change and instability. As the name implies, it was a period of disunity, when several different states were warring with each other to determine who would gain control of all of China and found a new dynasty. Under the pressure of competition, the old ways and political systems were being abandoned in the search for greater control over human and material resources and increased military power. The central question for most philosophers of the time was how to respond to this time of instability and achieve a greater measure of order and safety. For the Confucian philosophers, the answer was found in a revival of the ways of the past, and for Xunzi in particular, the most important aspect of that was the ritual system. In this sense, the ethical and political aspects of Xunzi’s philosophy are the core areas, and in fact were not sharply distinguished in most Confucian thought. Metaphysics and philosophy of language serve to further the goal of restoring social stability.

All of the Warring States philosophers assumed that the government should be a monarchy. The king was the ultimate authority in all areas of government, having full power to hire and dismiss (and execute) any other government official. There was no idea of democracy in early China. The ruler could lose his state through failing in his duties as a sovereign, but he could not be replaced at the whim of the people. The political thinkers of the time instead tried to impose checks through tradition and thought, rather than law. The Mohists made Heaven the watchdog over the ruler: if a ruler offended Heaven by mistreating the people, Heaven would have him removed through war or revolt. The Confucians also emphasized the duties of the ruler to the people, though in Xunzi’s case there was no personified Heaven watching over things. One of the functions of ritual was to try to put limits on the power of the ruler and emphasize his obligation to the people. Confucian thinkers, including Xunzi often viewed the state as a family. Just as a father must take care of his children, the ruler must take care of the people, and in return, the people will respond with loyalty. The Confucians also offered a very practical motive to care for the people: if the people were dissatisfied with the ruler, they would not fight on his behalf, and the state would be ripe for annexation by its neighbors.

b. Ritual and Music

Xunzi diagnosed the main cause of disorder as a breakdown of the social hierarchy. When hierarchical distinctions are confused and people do not follow their proper roles, they compete indiscriminately to satisfy their desires. The way to put limits on this competition is to clarify social distinctions: such as between ruler and subject, between older brother and younger brother, or between men and women. When everyone knows their place and what obligations and privileges they have, they will not contend for goods beyond their status. Not only will this result in order and stability, it actually will allow for greater satisfaction of everyone’s desires than the competition of the state of nature. This is the primary purpose of ritual: to clarify and enforce social distinctions, which will bring an end to contention for limited resources and improve social order. This, in turn, will ensure greater prosperity. The ritual tradition not only emphasized reciprocal obligations between people of different status, it had extremely precise regulations concerning who was allowed to own what kind of luxuries. There were rules concerning what colors of clothing different people could wear, who was allowed to ride in carriages, and what grave goods they could be buried with. The point of all these rules is to enforce the distinctions necessary for social harmony and prevent people from reaching beyond their station.

Without the benefit of ritual principles to enforce the social hierarchy, the identity of human nature makes conflict inevitable. By nature we all desire the same things: fine food, beautiful clothing, wealth, and comfort. Xunzi believes desires are inevitable. When most people see something beautiful, they will desire it: only the sage can control his desires. Because of limited resources, it is impossible for everyone to satisfy their desires for material goods. What people can do is decide whether to act on a desire or not. Ritual teaches people to channel, moderate, and in some cases transform their desires so they can satisfy them in appropriate ways. When it is right to do so one satisfies them, and when that is not possible one moderates them. This allows both the partial satisfaction of desires and the maintenance of social harmony. All of this is made possible by the ritual principles of the Way, when the alternative is the chaos of the state of nature. Hence, Xunzi wrote that Confucian teachings allow people to satisfy both the demands of ritual and their desires, when the alternative is satisfying neither.

Another important part of governing is music. The ancient Chinese believed that music was the most direct and effective way of influencing the emotions. Hence, only allowing the correct music to be played was crucial to governing the state. The right kinds of music, those attributed to the ancient sages, could both give people an outlet for emotions that could not be satisfied in other ways, like aggression, and channel their emotions and bring them in line with the Way. The wrong kind of music would instead encourage wanton, destructive behavior and cause a breakdown of social order. Because of its powerful effect on the emotions, music is as important a tool as ritual in moral education and in governing. Much as Plato suggested in the Republic, Xunzi believes regulating music is one of the duties of the state. It must promulgate the correct music to give people a legitimate source of emotional expression and ban unorthodox music to prevent it from upsetting the balance of society.

c. Moral Power

As he does with virtuous people, Xunzi distinguishes different levels of rulers. The lowest is the ruler who relies on military power to expand his territory, taxes excessively without regard for whether his people have enough to sustain themselves, and keeps them in line with laws and punishments. According to Xunzi, such a ruler is sure to come to a bad end. A ruler who governs efficiently, does not tax the people too harshly, gathers people of ability around him, and makes allies of the neighboring states can become a hegemon. The institution of the hegemon existed briefly about three hundred years before Xunzi’s time, but he often uses the term to connote an effective ruler who is still short of the highest level. The highest level is that of the true king who wins the hearts of the people through his rule by ritual principles. The moral power of the true king is so great that he can unify the whole country without a single battle, since the people will come to him of their own accord to live under his beneficent rule. According to Xunzi, this is how the sage kings of the past were able to unify the country even though they began as rulers of small states. The best kind of government is government through the moral power acquired by following the Way.

This concept of moral power was quite old in China even in Xunzi’s time, though initially it referred to the power gained from the spirits through sacrifice. Beginning with Confucius, it become ethicized into a kind of power or charisma that anyone who cultivated virtue and followed the Way developed. Through this moral power, a king could rule effectively without having to personally attend to the day-to-day business of governing. Following his example, the people would become virtuous as well, so crime would be minimal, and the ruler’s subordinates could carry out the necessary administrative tasks to run the state. In Confucian thought, the most important role of the ruler is that of moral example, which is why the best government was that of a sage who followed the ritual principles of the Way. Confucius seemed to believe that the moral power of a sage king would render laws and punishments completely unnecessary: the people would be transformed by the ruler’s moral power and never transgress the boundaries of what is right. Xunzi, while still believing in the efficacy of rule through moral force, is not quite as optimistic, which is likely related to his view on human nature. He thinks punishments will still be necessary because some people will break the law, but a sage king will only rarely need to employ punishments to keep the people in line, while a lord-protector or ordinary ruler will have to resort to them much more. This increased acceptance of the necessity for punishments may have influenced Xunzi’s student Han Feizi, to whom is attributed the most developed theory of government through a strict system of rewards and punishments that was employed by the short-lived Qin dynasty.

6. References and Further Reading

Cua, Antonio S. Ethical Argumentation: A Study in Hsün Tzu’s Moral Epistemology. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1985.
Dubs, Homer H. Hsüntze: Moulder of Ancient Confucianism. London: Arthur Probsthain, 1927. The first English-language monograph on Xunzi’s thought.
Goldin, Paul. Rituals of the Way. Chicago: Open Court, 1999. A good overview of the essentials of Xunzi’s thought.
Ivanhoe, Philip J. Confucian Moral Self Cultivation. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2000. An introduction to Confucian thought, focusing on the theme of self cultivation. Includes a chapter on Xunzi.
Kline, T.C. III and Philip J. Ivanhoe, eds. Virtue, Nature, and Moral Agency in the Xunzi. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2000. An excellent anthology bringing together much of the recent important work on Xunzi. The bibliography includes virtually every English publication related to Xunzi.
Knoblock, John, trans. Xunzi: A Translation and Study of the Complete Works, 3 vols. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1988, 1990, 1994. The only complete English translation of the Xunzi, with extensive introductory material.
Machle, Edward. Nature and Heaven in the Xunzi: A Study of the Tian Lun. Albany: SUNY Press, 1993. A translation and study of chapter seventeen, “Discourse on Heaven.”
Watson, Burton, trans. Hsün Tzu: Basic Writings. New York: Columbia University Press, 1964. An excerpted translation, including many of the more philosophically interesting chapters. It is easier for non-specialists than Knoblock.

Author Information

David Elstein
Email: davidelstein@world.oberlin.edu
State University of New York at New Paltz
U. S. A.

Xuanzang (Hsüan-tsang) (602—664)

Xuanzang, world-famous for his sixteen-year pilgrimage to India and career as a translator of Buddhist scriptures, is one of the most illustrious figures in the history of scholastic Chinese Buddhism. Born into a scholarly family at the outset of the Tang (T’ang) Dynasty, he enjoyed a classical Confucian education. Under the influence of his elder brother, a Buddhist monk, however, he developed a keen interest in Buddhist subjects and soon became a monk himself at the age of thirteen. Upon his return to Chang’an in 645, Xuanzang brought back with him a great number of Sanskrit texts, of which he was able to translate only a small portion during the remainder of his lifetime. In addition to his translations of the most essential Mahayana scriptures, Xuanzang authored the Da tang xi yu ji (Ta-T’ang Hsi-yu-chi or Records of the Western Regions of the Great T’ang Dynasty) with the aid of Bianji (Bian-chi). It is through Xuanzang and his chief disciple Kuiji (K’uei-chi) (632-682) that the Faxiang (Fa-hsiang or Yogacara/Consciousness-only) School was initiated in China. In order to honor the famous Buddhist scholar, the Tang Emperor Gaozong (Gao-tsung) cancelled all audiences for three days after Xuanzang’s death. (See Romanization systems for Chinese terms.)

Xuanzang’s Beginnings (602-630)
Pilgrimage to India (630-645)
His Return to China and Career as Translator (645-664)
The Faxiang School
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Xuanzang’s Beginnings (602-630)

Born of a family possessing erudition for generations in Yanshi prefecture of Henan province, Xuanzang, whose lay name was Chenhui, was the youngest of four children. His great-grandfather was an official serving as a prefect, his grand-father was appointed as Professor in the National College at the capital, and his father was a Confucianist of the rigid conservative type who gave up office and withdrew into seclusion to escape the political turmoil that gripped China at that time. According to traditional biographies, Xuanzang displayed a precocious intelligence and seriousness, amazing his father by his careful observance of the Confucian rituals at the age of eight. Along with his brothers and sister, he received an early education from his father, who instructed him in classical works on filial piety and several other canonical treatises of orthodox Confucianism.

After the death of Xuanzang’s father in 611, his older brother Chensu, later known as Changjie, became the primary influence on his life. As a result, he commenced visiting the monastery of Jingtu at Luoyang where his brother dwelled as a Buddhist monk, and studying sacred texts of the faith with all the ardor of a young convert. When Xuanzang requested to take Buddhist orders at the age of thirteen, the abbot Zheng Shanguo made an exception in his case because of his precocious sapience.

In 618, due to the civil war breaking out in Henan, Xuanzang and his brother sought refuge in the mountains of Sichuan, where he spent three years or so in the monastery of Kong Hui plunging into the study of various Buddhist texts, such as the Abhidharmakosa-sastra (Abhidharma Storehouse Treatise. In 622, he was fully ordained as a monk. Deeply confused by myriad contradictions and discrepancies in the texts, and not receiving any solutions from his Chinese masters, Xuanzang decided to go to India and study in the cradle of Buddhism.

2. Pilgrimage to India (630-645)

An imperial decree by the Emperor Taizong (T’ai-tsung) forbade Xuanzang’s proposed visit to India on the grounds on preserving national security. Instead of feeling deterred from his long-standing dream, Xuanzang is said to have experienced a vision that strengthened resolve. In 629, defying imperial proscription, he secretly set out on his epochal journey to the land of the Buddha from Chang’an.

Xuanzang reports that he travelled by night, hiding during the day, enduring many dangers, and bereft of a guide after being abandoned by his companions. After some time in the Gobi Desert, he arrived in Liangzhou in modern Gansu province, the westernmost extent of the Chinese frontier at that time and the southern terminus of the Silk Road trade route connecting China with Central Asia. Here he spent approximately a month preaching the Buddhist message before being invited to Hami by King Qu Wentai (Ch’u Wen-tai) of Turfan, a pious Buddhist of Chinese extraction.

It soon became apparent to Xuanzang that Qu Wentai, although most hospitable and respectful, planned to detain him for life in his Court as its ecclesiastical head. In response, Xuanzang undertook a hunger strike until the king relented, extracting from Xuanzang a promise to return and spend three years in the kingdom upon his return. After remaining there for a month more for the sake of the dharma, Xuanzang resumed his journey in 630, well provided with introductions to all the kings on his itinerary, including the formidable Turkish Khan whose power extended to the very gates of India. Having initially left China against the will of the Emperor, he was no longer an unknown fugitive fleeing in secret, but an accredited pilgrim with official standing.

At long last, Xuanzang reached his ultimate destination, where his strongest personal interest in Buddhism was located and the principal portion of his time abroad was spent: the Nalanda monastery, located southwest of the modern city of Bihar in northern Bihar state. As a far-famed metropolis of Buddhist monastic education, Nalanda was a veritable monastic city consisting of some ten huge temples with spaces between divided into eight compounds, surrounded by a high wall. There were over ten thousand Mahayana monks there engaged in the study of the orthodox Buddhist canon as well as the Vedas, arithmetic, and medicine. According to legend, Silabhadra (529-645), abbot of Nalanda, was considering suicide after years of wasting illness when he received instructions from deities in a dream, commanding him to endure and await the arrival of a Chinese monk in order to guarantee the preservation of the Mahayana tradition abroad. Indeed, Xuanzang became Silabhadra’s disciple in 636 and was initiated into the Yogacara lineage of Mahayana learning by the venerable abbot. While at Nalanda, Xuanzang also studied Sanskrit and Brahmana philosophy. Subsequent studies in India included hetu-vidya (logic), the exegesis of Mahayana texts such as the Mahayana-sutralamkara (Treatise on the Scripture of Adorning the Great Vehicle), and Madhyamika (“Middle-ist”) doctrines.

The name of the Madhyamika School, founded by Nagarjuna (2^nd century CE), derives from its having sought a middle position between the realism of the Sarvastivada (Doctrine That All Is Real) School and the idealism of the Yogacara (Mind Only) School. Xuanzang appears to have combined these two systems into each other in a more eclectic and comprehensive Mahayanism. With the approval of his Nalanda mentors, Xuanzang composed a treatise, Hui zong lun (Hui-tsüng-lun or On the Harmony of the Principles), which articulates his synthesis.

At Nalanda, Xuanzang became a critic of two major philosophical systems of Hinduism opposed to Buddhism: the Samkhya and the Vaiseshika. The former was based upon a dualism of Nature and Spirit. The latter was a realist system, immediate and direct in its realism, resting upon the acceptance of the data of consciousness and experience as such: in brief, it was a melding of monism and atomism. Such beliefs were in absolute contradiction to the acosmic idealism of the Buddhist Yogacara, which evenly repelled the substantial entity of the ego and the objective existence of matter. Xuanzang also critiqued the atheistic monism of the Jains, especially inveighing against what he saw as their caricature of Buddhism in terms of Jain monastic garb and iconography.

Xuanzang’s success in religious and philosophical disputes evidently aroused the attention of some Indian potentates, including the King of Assam and the poet-cum-dramatist king Harsha (r. 606-647), who was regarded as a Buddhist patron saint upon the throne like Ashoka and Kanishka of old. An eighteen-day religious assembly was convoked in Harsha’s capital of Kanauj during the first week of the year 643, during which Xuanzang allegedly defeated five hundred Brahmins, Jains, and heterodox Buddhists in spirited debate.

Following these public successes in India, Xuanzang resolved to return to China by way of Central Asia. He followed the caravan-track that led across the Pamirs to Dunhuang. In the spring of 644, he reached Khotan and awaited a reply to his request for return addressed to the Emperor Taizong. In the month of November, Xuanzang left for Dunhuang by a decree of the Emperor, and arrived in the Chinese capital Chang’an the first month of the Chinese Lunar Year 645.

3. His Return to China and Career as Translator (645-664)

Traditional sources report that Xuanzang’s arrival in Chang’an was greeted with an imperial audience and an offer of official position (which Xuanzang declined), followed by an assembly of all the Buddhist monks of the capital city, who accepted the manuscripts, relics, and statues brought back by the pilgrim and deposited them in the Temple of Great Happiness. It was in this Temple that Xuanzang devoted the rest of his life to the translation of the Sanskrit works that he had brought back out of the wide west, assisted by a staff of more than twenty translators, all well-versed in the knowledge of Chinese, Sanskrit, and Buddhism itself. Besides translating Buddhist texts and dictating the Da tang xi yu ji in 646, Xuanzang also translated the Dao de jing (Tao-te Ching) of Laozi (Lao-tzu) into Sanskrit and sent it to India in 647.

His translations may, by and large, be divided into three phases: the first six years (645-650), focusing on the Yogacarabhumi-sastra; the middle ten years (651-660), centering on the Abhidharmakosa-sastra; and the last four years (661-664), concentrating upon the Maha-prajnaparamita-sutra. In each phase of his career as a translator, Xuanzang saw his task as introducing Indian Buddhist texts to Chinese audiences in all their integrity. According to Thomas Watters, the total number of texts brought by Xuanzang from India to China is six hundred and fifty seven, enumerated as follows:

Mahayanist sutras: 224 items
Mahayanist sastras: 192
Sthavira sutras, sastras and Vinaya: 14
Mahasangika sutras, sastras and Vinaya: 15
Mahisasaka sutras, sastras and Vinaya: 22
Sammitiya sutras, sastras and Vinaya: 15
Kasyapiya sutras, sastra and Vinaya: 17
Dharmagupta sutras, Vinaya, sastras: 42
Sarvastivadin sutras, Vinaya, sastras: 67
Yin-lun (Treatises on the science of Inference): 36
Sheng-lun (Etymological treatises): 13

4. The Faxiang School

a. The Development of Yogacara

The Chinese Faxiang School, derived from the Indian Yogacara (yoga practice) School, is based upon the writings of two brothers, Asanga and Vasubandhu, who explicated a course of practice wherein hindrances are removed according to a sequence of stages, from which it gets its name. The appellation of the school originated with the title of an important fourth- or fifth-century CE text of the school, the Yogacarabhumi-sastra. Yogacara attacked both the provisional practical realism of the Madhyamika School of Mahayana Buddhism and the complete realism of Theravada Buddhism. Madhyamika is regarded as the nihilistic or Emptiness School, whereas Yogacara is seen as the realistic or Existence School. While the former is characterized as Mahayana due to its central theme of emptiness, the latter might be considered to be semi-Mahayana to a point for three basic reasons: (1) the Yogacara remains realistic like the Abhidharma School; (2) it expounds the three vehicles side by side without being confined to the Bodhisattvayana; and (3) it does not accent the doctrine of Buddha nature.

The other name of the school, Vijnanavada (Consciousness-affirming/Doctrine of Consciousness), is more descriptive of its philosophical position, which in short is that the reality a human being perceives does not exist. Yogacara becomes much better known, nevertheless, not for its practices, but for its rich development in psychological and metaphysical theory. The Yogacara thinkers took the theories of the body-mind aggregate of sentient beings that had been under development in earlier Indian schools such as the Sarvastivada, and worked them into a more fully articulated scheme of eight consciousnesses, the most weighty of which was the eighth, or store consciousness — the alaya-vijnana.

The Yogacara School is also known for the development of other key concepts that would hold great influence not merely within their system, but within all forms of later Mahayana to come. They embody the theory of the three natures of the dependently originated, completely real, and imaginary, which are understood as a Yogacara response to the Madhyamika’s truth of emptiness. Yogacara is also the original source for the theory of the three bodies of the Buddha, and greatly expands the notions of categories of elemental constructs.

Yogacara explored and propounded basic doctrines that were to be fundamental in the future growth of Mahayana and that influenced the rise of Tantric Buddhism. Its central doctrine is that only consciousness (vijnanamatra; hence the name Vijnanavada) is real, and that mind is the ultimate reality. In other words, external objects do not exist; nothing exists outside the mind. The common view that external phenomena exist is due to a misconception that is removable through a meditative or yogic process, which brings a complete withdrawal from these fictitious externals, and an inner concentration and tranquility may accordingly be bodied forth.

Yogacara is an alternative system of Buddhist logic. According to it, the object is not at all as it seems, and thus can not be of any service to knowledge. It is therefore unreal when consciousness is the sole reality. The object is only a mode of consciousness. Its appearance although objective and external is in fact the transcendental illusion, because of which consciousness is bifurcated into the subject-object duality. Consciousness is creative and its creativity is governed by the illusive idea of the object. Reality is to be viewed as an Idea or a Will. This creativity is manifested at different levels of consciousness.

Since this school believes that only ideation exists, it is also called the Idealistic School. In China, it was established by Xuanzang and his principal pupil Kuiji who systematized the teaching of his masters recorded in two essential works: the Fa yuan i lin zhang (Fa-yuan i-lin-chang or Chapter on the Forest of Meanings in the Garden of Law) and the Cheng wei shi lun shu ji (Ch’eng wei-shih lun shu-chi or Notes on the Treatise on the Completion of Ideation Only). On account of the school’s idealistic accent it is known as Weishi (Wei-shih) or Ideation Only School; yet because it is concerned with the specific character of all the dharmas, it is often called the Faxiang School as well. Besides, this school argues that not all beings possess pure seeds and, therefore, not all of them are capable of attaining Buddhahood.

The central concept of this school is borrowed from a statement by Vasubandhu — idam sarvam vijnaptimatrakam, “All this world is ideation only.” It strongly claims that the external world is merely a fabrication of our consciousness, that the external world does not exist, and that the internal ideation presents an appearance as if it were an outer world. The whole external world is, hence, an illusion according to it.

b. Metaphysics of Mere-Consciousness

Broadly speaking, Mere-Consciousness may cover the eight consciousnesses, the articulation of which forms one of the most seminal and distinctive aspects of the doctrine of the Yogacara School, transmitted to East Asia where it received the somewhat pejorative designations of Dharma-character School and Consciousness-only School. According to this doctrine, sentient beings possess eight distinct layers of consciousness, the first five — the visual consciousness, auditory consciousness, olfactory consciousness, gustatory consciousness, and tactile consciousness — corresponding to the sense perceptions, the sixth discriminatory consciousness to the thinking mind, the seventh manas consciousness to the notion of ego, and the eighth alaya-consciousness to the repository of all the impressions from one’s past experiences. As the first seven of these arise on the basis of the eighth, they are called the transformed consciousnesses. In contrast, the eighth is known as the base consciousness, store consciousness, or seed consciousness. And in particular, it is this last consciousness that the Mere-Consciousness is all about.

One of the foremost themes discussed in the school is the

alaya-vijnana or storehouse consciousness, which stores and coordinates all the notions reflected in the mind. Thus, it is a storehouse where all the pure and contaminated ideas are blended or interfused. This principle might be illustrated by the school’s favorite citation:

“A seed produces a manifestation,
A manifestation perfumes a seed.
The three elements (seed, manifestation, and perfume) turn on and on,
The cause and effect occur at one and the same time.”

It is the doctrine of consciousness or mind as the basis for so-called “external” objects that gave the Cittamatra (Mind Only) tradition its name. Apparently external objects are constituted by consciousness and do not exist apart from it. Vasubandhu began his

Vimsatika vijnapti-matrata-siddhih (Twenty Verses on Consciousness-only) by stating: “All this is only perception, since consciousness manifests itself in the form of nonexistent objects.” There is only a flow of perceptions. This flow, however, really exists, and it is mental by nature, as in terms of the Buddhist division of things it has to be either mental or physical. The flow of experiences could barely be a physical or material flow. There might be a danger in calling this “idealism,” because it is rather dissimilar from forms of idealism in Western philosophy, in which it is deemed necessary for a newcomer to negate and transcend previous theories and philosophies through criticism, but the situation in Buddhism, especially Yogacara Buddhism, is such that it developed its doctrines by inheriting the entire body of thought of its former masters. Nonetheless, if “idealism” denotes that subjects and objects are no more than a flow of experiences and perceptions, which are of the same nature, and these experiences, just as perceptions, are mental, then this could be called a form of “dynamic idealism.”

Because this school maintains that no external reality exists, while retaining the position that knowledge exists, assuming knowledge itself is the object of consciousness. It, therefore, postulates a higher storage consciousness, which is the final basis of the apparent individual. The universe consists in an infinite number of possible ideas that lie inactively in storage. Such dormant consciousness projects an interrupted sequence of thoughts, while it itself is in restless flux till the karma, or accumulated consequences of past deeds, blows out. This storage consciousness takes in all the impressions of previous experiences, which shape up the seeds of future karmic action, an illusory force creating outer categories that are actually only fictions of the mind. So illusive a force determines the world of difference and belongs to human nature, sprouting the erroneous notions of an I and a non-I. That duality can only be conquered by enlightenment, which effects the transformation of an ordinary person into a Buddha.

c. Some Objections Answered

Certain objections were interposed to level at Yogacara’s doctrine of consciousness. Vasubhandhu, again in his Vimsatika, undertook to prove the invalidity of some of these:

Spatiotemporal determination would be impossible — experiences of object X are not occurrent everywhere and at every time so there must be some external basis for our experiences.
Many people experience X and not just one person, as in the case of a hallucination.
Hallucinations can be determined because they do not possess pragmatic results. It does not follow that entities, which we generally accept as real, can be placed in the same class.

In reply, Vasubandhu argued that these were after all no objections; they simply failed to show that perception-only as a teaching was beyond the limits of what could be concretely reasoned. Spatiotemporal determination can be elucidated on the analogy of dream experience, where a complete and surreal world is created with objects appearing to have spatiotemporal localization despite the fact that they do not exist apart from the mind which is cognizing them. Moreover, the second objection can be met by recourse to the wider Buddhist religious framework. The hells and their tortures, which are taught by Buddhist beliefs as the result of wicked deeds, and to be endured for a very long time till purified, are experienced as the collective fruit of the previous karmas done by those hell inmates. The torturers of hell obviously can not really exist, otherwise they would have been reborn in hell themselves and would too experience the sufferings associated with it. If this were the case then how could they jovially inflict sufferings upon their fellow inmates? Thus they must be illusive, and yet they are experienced by a number of people. Finally, as in a dream objects bear some pragmatic purpose within that dream, and likewise in hell, so in everyday life. Furthermore, as physical activity can be directed toward unreal objects in a dream owing, it is said, to nervous irritation on the part of the dreamer, so too in daily life.

e. The Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra

Representing a two-hundred-year development within the Vijnanavadin tradition subsequent to the Lankavatara Sutra (Sutra on the Buddha’s Entering the Country of Lanka) and being the primary text of the Faxiang School, the Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra is an exhaustive study of the alaya-vijnana and the sevenfold development of the manas, manovijnana, and the five sensorial consciousnesses. As a creative and elaborate exposition of Vasubandhu’s Trimsika-vijnapti-matrata-siddhi (Treatise in Thirty Stanzas on Consciousness Only) rendered by Xuanzang in 648 at Great Happiness Monastery, it synthesizes the ten most significant commentaries written on it, and becomes the enchiridion of the new Faxiang School of Buddhist idealism. It is mainly a translation by Xuanzang in 659 of Dharmapala’s commentary on the Trimsika-vijnapti-matrata-siddhi, yet it also contains edited translations of other masters’ works on the same verses. This is the only translation by Xuanzang that is not a direct translation of a text, but instead a selective and evaluative editorial drawing on ten distinct texts. Since Kuiji aligned himself with this text as assuming the role of Xuanzang’s successor, the East Asian tradition has treated the Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra as the pivotal exemplar of Xuanzang’s teachings.
In both style and content, the Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra symbolizes a superior advance over the earlier Lankavatara Sutra, a basic Faxiang School’s canonical text that sets forth quite a few hallmarks of Mahayana position, such as the eight consciousnesses and the tathagatagarbha (Womb of the Buddha-to-be). Instead of bearing the latter’s cryptically aphoristic form, Xuanzang’s treatise is a detailed and coherent analysis, a scholastic apologetics on the doctrine of Consciousness-only. Without any reference to the tathagatagarbha itself, the Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra firmly grounds its pan-consciousness upon Absolute Suchness or the existence of the mind as true reality. Aside from human consciousness, another principle is accepted as real — the so-called suchness, which is the equivalent of the void of the Madhyamika School.

The Vijnaptimatratasiddhi-sastra spells out how there can be a common empirical world for different individuals who ideate or construct particular objects, and who possess distinct bodies and sensory systems. According to Xuanzang, the universal “seeds” in the store consciousness account for the common appearance of things, while particular “seeds” make a description of the differences.

f. Faxiang Doctrines

Being a first and foremost idealistic school of Mahayana Buddhism, the Faxiang School categorically discerns chimerical phenomena manifested in consistent patterns of regularity and continuity; in order to justify this order in which only defiled elements could prevail before enlightenment is attained, it created the tenet of the alaya-vijnana. Sense perceptions are commanded as regular and coherent by a store of consciousnesses, of which one is consciously unaware. Then, sense impressions produce certain configurations in this insensibility that “perfumate” later impressions so that they appear consistent and regular. Each and every single one of beings possesses this seed consciousness, which therefore becomes a sort of collective consciousness that takes control of human perceptions of the world, though this world does not exist at all according to the very tenet. This school’s forerunner had emerged in India roughly the second century AD, yet had its period of greatest productivity in the fourth century, during the time of Asanga and Vasubandha. Following them, the school divided into two branches, the Nyayanusarino Vijnanavadinah (Vijnanavada School of the Logical Tradition) and the Agamanusarino Vijnanavadinah (Vijnanavada School of the Scriptural Tradition), with the former sub-school postulating the standpoints of the logician Dignaga (c. AD 480-540) and his successor, Dharmakirti (c. AD 600?-680?).

This consciousness-oriented school of ideology was largely represented in China by the Faxiang School, called Popsang in Korea, and Hosso in Japan. The radical teachings of Yogacara became known in China primarily through a work of Paramartha, a sixth-century Indian missionary-translator. His rendition of the Mahayana-samparigraha-sastra (Compendium of the Great Vehicle) by Asanga provided a sound base for the Sanlun (Three-Treatise) School, which preceded the Faxiang School as the vehicle of Yogacara thought in China. Faxiang is the Chinese translation of the Sanskrit term dharmalaksana (characteristic of dharma), referring to the school’s basal emphasis on the unique characteristics of the dharmas that make up the world, which appears in human ideation. According to Faxiang doctrines, there are five categories of dharmas: (1) eight mental dharmas, encompassing the five sense consciousnesses, cognition, the cognitive faculty, and the store consciousness; (2) eleven elements relating to appearances or material forms; (3) fifty-one mental capacities or functions, activities, and dispositions; (4) twenty-four situations, processes, and things not associated with the mind — for example, time and becoming; and (5) six non-conditioned or non-created elements — for instance, space and the nature of existence.

Alaya–consciousness is posited as the receptacle of the imprint of thoughts and deeds, thus it is the dwelling of sundry karmic seeds. These “germs” develop into form, feeling, perception, impulse, and consciousness, collectively known as the Five Aggregates. Then ideation gradually takes shape, which triggers off a self or mind against an outer world. Finally comes the awareness of the objects of thought via sense perceptions and ideas. The store consciousness must be purified of its subject-object duality and notions of false existence, and restored to its pure state tantamount to buddhahood, the Absolute Suchness, and the undifferentiated. In line with these three elements of false imagination, right knowledge, and suchness is the three modes in which things respectively are: (1) the mere fictions of false imagination; (2) under certain conditions to relatively exist; and (3) in the perfect mode of being. Corresponding to this threefold version of the modes of existence is the tri-body doctrine of the Buddha — the Dharma Body, the Reward Body, and the Response Body, a creed that was put into its systematic and highly developed theory by Yogacara thinkers. The distinguishing features of the Faxiang School lie in its highlight of meditation and broadly psychological analyses. Seen in this light, it is a fry cry from the other predominant Mahayana stream, Madhyamika, where the stress is entirely upon dialectics and logical arguments.

The base consciousness is interpreted as the container of the karmic impressions or seeds, nourished by us beings in the process of our existence. These seeds, ripening in the course of future circumstances, find the nearest parallel to the present-day understanding of genes. In view of the foregoing, philosophers of this school have constantly essayed to explain in detail how karmic force actually operates and affects us on a concrete, personal level. Comprised in this development of consciousness theory is the concept of conscious justification — phenomena that are presumably external to us can never exist but in intimate association with consciousness itself. Such a notion is commonly referred to as “Mind Only.”

The fundamental early canonical texts that expound Yogacara doctrines are such scriptures as the (Sutra on Understanding Profound and Esoteric Doctrine, the Srimala-sutra (Sutra on the Lion’s Roar of Queen Srimala), and treatises like the Mahayana-samparigraha-sastra, the Prakaranaryavaca-sastra (Acclamation of the Scriptural Teaching), and the Yogacarabhumi, etc.

5. Conclusion

As an early and influential Chinese Buddhist monk, Xuanzang embodies the tensions inherent in Chinese Buddhism: filial piety versus monastic discipline, Confucian orthodoxy versus Mahayana progressivism, etc. Such tensions can be seen not only in his personal legacies, which include the extremely popular Chinese novel based on his travels, Xiyouji (Journey to the West), but also in the career of scholastic Buddhism in China.

For a time during the middle of the Tang Dynasty the Faxiang School achieved a high degree of eminence and popularity across China, but after the passing of Xuanzang and Kuiji the school swiftly declined. One of the factors resulting in this decadence was the anti-Buddhist imperial persecutions of 845. Another likely factor was the harsh criticism of Faxiang by members of the Huayan (Hua-yen) School. In addition, the philosophy of this school, with its abstruse terminology and hairsplitting analysis of the mind and the senses, was too alien to be accepted by the practical-minded Chinese.

6. References and Further Reading

Bapat, P. V., and K. A. Nilakanta Sastri, eds. 2500 Years of Buddhism. Delhi: Government of India Press, 1964.
Bernstein, Richard. Ultimate Journey: Retracing the Path of an Ancient Buddhist Monk Who Crossed Asia in Search of Enlightenment: Alfred A. Knopf, 2001.
Brown, Brian Edward. The Buddha Nature: A Study of the Tathagatagarbha and Alayavijnana. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1991.
Ch’en, Kenneth K. S. Buddhism in China: A Historical Survey. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1973.
Chatterjee, Ashok Kumar. The Yogacara Idealism. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1987.
The Unknown Hsuan-Tsang. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001.Edkins, Joseph. Chinese Buddhism: A Volume of Sketches, Historical, Descriptive and Critical. San Francisco: Chinese Materials Center, 1976.
Grousset, Rene. In the Footsteps of the Buddha. San Francisco: Chinese Materials Center, 1976.
Hwui Li. The life of Hiuen-Tsiang. London: Kegan Paul, Trench, and Trubner, 1911.
Kieschnick, John. The Eminent Monk: Buddhist Ideals in Medieval Chinese Hagiography. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1997.
Lan Ji-fu, ed. The Chung-hwa Fo Jian Bai Ke Quan Shu: Religious Affairs Committee of Foguangshan Buddhist Order, 1993.
Lusthaus, Dan. Buddhist Phenomenology: A Philosophical Investigation of Yogacara Buddhism and the Ch’eng Wei-shih lun. London: Routledge Curzon, 2002.
Nagao, Gadjin M. Madhyamika and Yogacara: A Study of Mahayana Philosophies. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1991.
Pachow, W. Chinese Buddhism: Aspects of Interaction and Reinterpretation. Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1980.
Sharf, Robert H. Coming to Terms with Chinese Buddhism: A Reading of the Treasure Store Treatise. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 2002.
Waley, Arthur. The Real Tripitaka, and Other Pieces. London: George Allen & Unwin, 1952.
Watters, Thomas. On Yuan Chwang’s Travels in India: A. D. 629-645. Delhi: Munshiram Manoharlal, 1996.
William, Paul, Mahayana Buddhism (The Doctrinal Foundations). London: Routledge, 1991.
Wriggins, Sally Hovey. Xuanzang: A Buddhist Pilgrim on the Silk Road. Boulder: Westview Press, 1996.

Author Information

Der Huey Lee
Email: leederhuey@hotmail.com
Peking University
China

Vienna Circle

The Vienna Circle is a group of philosophers who gathered around Moritz Schlick, after his coming in Vienna in 1922. They organized a philosophical association, named Verein Ernst Mach (Ernst Mach Association). However, meetings on philosophy of science and epistemology began as early as 1907, promoted by Frank, Hahn and Neurath, who later arranged to bring Schlick at the University of Vienna. Among Vienna Circle’s members were M. Schlick, Rudolf Carnap, H. Feigl, P. Frank, K. Gödel, H. Hahn, V. Kraft, O. Neurath, F. Waismann. Also K. R. Popper and H. Kelsen had many contacts with the Vienna Circle, although they did not belong to it. At the meetings, the Tractatus of Ludwig Wittgenstein was also discussed, and there were several meetings between Wittgenstein, Schlick, Waismann and Carnap. In 1929 Hahn, Neurath and Carnap published the manifesto of the circle: Wissenschaftliche Weltauffassung. Der Wiener Kreis (A scientific world-view. The Vienna Circle).

Vienna Circle was very active in advertising the new philosophical ideas of logical positivism. Several congresses on epistemology and philosophy of science were organized, with the help of the Berlin Circle. There were some preparatory congresses: Prague (1929), Könisberg (1930), Prague (1934) and then the first congress on scientific philosophy held in Paris (1935), followed by congresses in Copenhagen (1936), Paris (1937), Cambridge, England (1938), Cambridge, Mass. (1939). The Könisberg congress (1930) was very important, because Gödel announced he had proved the completeness of first order logic and the incompleteness of arithmetic. Another very interesting congress was the one held in Copenhagen (1936), which was dedicated to quantum physics and causality.

Between 1928 and 1937, the Vienna Circle published ten books in a series named Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung (Papers on the Scientific Worldview), edited by Schlick and Frank. Among these works was Logik der Forschung, 1935, which is the first book published by K. R. Popper. Seven works were published in another series, called Einheitswissenschaft (Unified Science), edit by Carnap, Frank, Hahn, Neurath, Joergensen (after Hahn’s death) and Morris (from 1938). In 1930 Carnap and Hans Reichenbach undertook the editorship of the journal Erkenntnis, which was published between 1930 and 1940 (from 1939 the editors were Neurath, Carnap and Morris).

The following is the list of works published in the two series edited by the Vienna Circle.

(1) Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung (Papers on scientific world-view), edit by Schlick and Frank.

R. von Mises, Wahrscheinlichkeit, Statistik und Wahrheit, 1928 (Probability, statistics, and truth, New York : Macmillan company, 1939)
R. Carnap, Abriss der Logistik, 1929
M. Schlick, Fragen der Ethik, 1930 (Problems of ethics, New York : Prentice-Hall, 1939)
O. Neurath, Empirische Soziologie, 1931
P. Frank, Das Kausalgesetz und seine Grenzen, 1932 (The law of causality and its limits, Dordrecth ; Boston : Kluwer, 1997)
O. Kant, Zur Biologie der Ethik, 1932
R. Carnap, Logische Syntax der Sprache, 1934 (The logical syntax of language, New York : Humanities, 1937)
K. R. Popper, Logik der Forschung, 1934 (The logic of scientific discovery, New York : Basic Books, 1959)
J. Schächeter, Prologomena zu einer kritischen Grammatik, 1935 (Prolegomena to a critical grammar, Dordrecth ; Boston : D. Reidel Pub. Co., 1973)
V. Kraft, Die Grundlagen einer wissenschaftliche Wertlehre, 1937 (Foundations for a scientific analysis of value, Dordrecth ; Boston : D. Reidel Pub. Co., 1981)

(2) Einheitswissenschaft (Unified science), edit by Carnap, Frank, Hahn, Neurath, Joergensen (after Hahn’s death), Morris (from 1938)

H. Hahn, Logik, Mathematik und Naturerkennen, 1933
O. Neurath, Einheitswissenschaft und Psychologie, 1933
R. Carnap, Die Aufgabe der Wissenschaftlogik, 1934
P. Frank, Das Ende der mechanistichen Physik, 1935
O. Neurath, Was bedeutet rationale Wirtschaftsbetrachtung, 1935
O. Neurath, E. Brunswik, C. Hull, G. Mannoury, J. Woodger, Zur Enzyclopädie der Einheitswissenschaft. Vorträge, 1938
R. von Mises, Ernst Mach und die empiritische Wissenschaftauffasung, 1939

These works are translated in Unified science – The Vienna Circle monograph series originally edited by Otto Neurath, Kluwer, 1987.

The members of the Vienna Circle were dispersed when the Nazi Party came to power in Germany; many of them emigrated to the U.S.A., where they taught in several universities. Schlick remained in Austria, but in 1936 he was killed by a Nazi sympathizer student in the University of Vienna.

Author Information

Mauro Murzi
Italy

Vasubandhu (fl. 4th or 5th cn. C.E.)

Vasubandhu was a prominent Buddhist teacher and one of the most important figures in the development of Mahyna Buddhism in India. Though he is particularly admired by later Buddhists as co-founder of the Yogcra school along with his half brother Asanga, his pre-Yogcra works, such as the Abhidharmakosha and his auto-commentary (Abhidharmakoshabhshya) on it, are considered masterpieces. He wrote commentaries on many stras, works on logic, devotional poetry, works on Abhidharma classifications, as well as original and innovative philosophical treatises. Some of his writings have survived in their original Sanskrit form, but many others, particularly his commentaries, are extant only in their Chinese or Tibetan translations. Vasubandhu was a many-sided thinker, and his personality as it emerges from his works and his biographies shows him as a man who was not only a great genius and a philosopher, but also a human being who was filled with great compassion.

Sources on the Biography of Vasubandhu
Early Life of Vasubandhu
Conversion to Mahayana
Intellectual Debates
Date of Vasubandhu
Writings of Vasubandhu
References and Further Readings

1. Sources on the Biography of Vasubandhu

The most important and the only complete account of the life of Vasubandhu entitled Posou pandoufa shijuan (Biography of Master Vasubandhu) was compiled into Chinese by Paramartha (499-569 C.E.), one of the chief exponents of Yogacara doctrine in China. It is preserved in the Chinese Tripitaka and its English translation was published by J. Takakusu in T’oung Pao (1904: 269-296). Apart from this account, the Xiyuji of Xuanzang (600-664 C.E.) also provides important information about the life of Vasubandhu. Though Paramartha and Xuanzang are the two most credible authorities for Vasubandhu’s life, yet serious discrepancies exist between their accounts. Paramartha’s account not only contains legendary or even mythical elements, but the time sequence of events is also ambiguous and differs greatly in places from the account of Xuanzang’s the Xiyuji. The Tibetan historians, Taranatha and Bu-ston, also give some important information on Vasubandhu’s life, but their account further disagrees with Paramartha and Xuanzang in terms of certain names and events associated with the life of Vasubandhu. Scholars once suspected that more than one person bore the name Vasubandhu in the history of Indian Buddhism, although recent studies have eliminated this hypothesis.

2. Early Life of Vasubandhu

He was born at Purusapura (identified with modern Peshawar, capital of North-West Frontier Province of Pakistan) in the state of Gandhara. Gandhara is best known today as one of the earliest regions to develop a distinctive form of Buddhist art noted for its Hellenistic influence. According to Taranatha, Vasubandhu was born one year after his older brother Asanga became a Buddhist monk. His father was a brahmanaof the Kaushika gotra. According to Posou pandou fashi zhuan his mother’s name was Virinci. But Bu-ston and Taranatha mention the name of the mother of Asanga and Vasubandhu as Prasannashila. According to these two Tibetan historians, Asanga and Vasubandhu were half-brothers; Asanga’s father being a kshatriya, and Vasubandhu’s a brahmana. Vasubandhu also had a younger brother called Virincivatsa. Vasubandhu’s father was a court priest, and according to Taranatha was an authority on the Vedas. In all probability, he officiated at the court of the Shaka princes of the Shilada clan, who at that time ruled from Purusapura. During the formative years of his life, Vasubandhu may have been introduced by his father not only to the Brahmanical tradition but also to the postulates of classical Nyaya and Vaisheshika, both of which had influence on his logical thought.

As a young student, he amazed his teachers with his brilliance and ready wit. According to Paramartha, Vasubandhu’s teacher was called Buddhamitra. The Xiyuji, however, never mentions Buddhamitra and names Manoratha as the teacher of Vasubandhu. At Vasubandhu’s time the dominant Buddhist school in Gandhara was the Vaibhashika (also called Sarvastivada). Vasubandhu entered the Sarvastivada order, and studied primarily the scholastic system of the Vaibhashikas. Initially, he was quite impressed with the Mahavibhasha. In time, however, Vasubandhu began to have grave doubts about the validity and relevance of Vaibhashika metaphysics. At this time, perhaps through the brilliant teacher Manoratha, he came into contact with the theories of the Sautrantikas, the group of Buddhists who wished to reject everything that was not the express word of the Buddha, and who held the elaborate constructions of the Vibhasha up to ridicule. That there was a strong Sautrantika tradition in Purusapura is likely in view of the fact that it was the birthplace of that maverick philosopher of the second century, Dharmatrata. In fact, the most orthodox Vaibhashika seat of learning was not in Gandhara, but in Kashmir, whose masters looked down upon the Gandharans as quasi-heretics. Therefore, according to Xuanzang’s pupil Pu Kuang, Vasubandhu decided to go to Kashmir disguised as a lunatic to investigate the Vaibhashika teachings more deeply. Vasubandhu studied in Kashmir with different teachers for four years and then came back to Purusapura.

After having returned to his native place, Vasubandhu began to prepare for an enormous project that had been in his mind for some time. At this time he was unattached to any particular order, and lived in a small private house in the center of Purusapura. Vasubandhu supported himself by lecturing on Buddhism before the general public, which presumably remunerated him with gifts. According to tradition, during the day he would lecture on Vaibhashika doctrine and in the evening distill the day’s lectures into a verse. When collected together the six hundred plus verses (karikas) gave a thorough summary of the entire system. He entitled this work the Abhidharmakosha (Treasury of Abhidharma). According to Paramartha, Vasubandhu composed the Abhidharmakosha at Ayodhya, but according to Xuanzang, it was composed in the suburbs of Purusapura. In the Abhidharmakosha Vasubandhu analyzed and catalogued seventy-five dharmas, the basic factors of experience, for the purposes of attaining Bodhi. He divided them into various categories consisting of eleven types of rupani i.e., ‘material forms’ (the five sense organs, their corresponding objects, and avijnapti-rupa i.e., ‘gesture unrevealing of intent’); citta (mind); ten types of mahaabhumika i.e., ‘major groundings’ (volition, desire, mindfulness, attention, and so forth); ten types of kushala-mahabhumika i.e., ‘advantageous major groundings’ (faith, vigor, equanimity, ahimsa, serenity, and so forth); six types of klesha-mahabhumika i.e., ‘mental disturbance major groundings’ (confusion, carelessness, restlessness, and so forth); two types of akushala mahabhumika i.e., ‘nonadvantageous major groundings (shamelessness and non-embarrassment); ten types of paritta-klesha-mahabhumika i.e., ‘secondary mental disturbance major groundings’ (anger, enmity, envy, conceit, and so forth); eight types of aniyata-mahabhumika i.e., ‘indeterminate major groundings’ (remorse, arrigance, aversion, doubt, torpor, and so forth); fourteen types of citta-viprayukta-samskara-dharmah i.e. ‘embodied-conditioning disassociated from mind’ (life-force, birth, decay, impermanence, and so forth); and three types of asamskrita-dharmah i.e., ‘unconditioned dharmas (spatiality, cessation through understanding, and cessation without understanding). Not only were the definitions and interrelations of these seventy-five dharmas analyzed in the Abhidharmakosha, but their karmic qualities also examined. Besides, Vasubandhu also elaborated upon causal theories, cosmology, practices of meditation, theories of perception, karma, rebirth, and the characteristics of an Enlightened Being in this text.

As the Abhidharmakosha was an eloquent summary of the purport of the Mahavibhasha, the Kashmiri Sarvastivadins are reported to have rejoiced to see in it all their doctrines so well propounded. Accordingly, they requested Vasubandhu to write a prose commentary (bhashya) on it. However, it seems that after having written the Abhidharmakosha, Vasubandhu began to have second thoughts about the Vaibhashika teachings. As a consequence, it is said, Vasubandhu prepared the Abhidharmakoshabhashya. But as it contained a thoroughgoing critique of Vaibhashika dogmatics from a Sautrantika viewpoint, the Kashmiri Sarvastivadins soon realized, to their great disappointment, that the Abhidharmakoshabhashya in fact refuted many Sarvastivada theories and upheld the doctrines of the Sautrantika school. One major point that created bad blood between the Vaibhashikas and the Sautrantikas was concerning the status and nature of the dharmas. The Vaibhashikas held that the dharmas exist in the past and future as well as the present. On the other hand, the Sautrantikas held the view that they are discrete, particular moments only existing at the present moment in which they discharge causal efficacy. The Vaibhashikas wrote several treatises attempting to refute Vasubandhu’s critiques.

3. Conversion to Mahayana

In the years directly following the composition of the Abhidharmakoshabhashya, Vasubandhu seems to have spent much time in travelling from place to place. Finally, after having spent some time at Shakala/ Shagala (modern Sialkot in Pakistan), he shifted along with his teachers Buddhamitra and Manoratha to Ayodhya (now located in Uttar Pradesh, northern India), a city far removed from Kashmir. According to Posou pandou fashi zhuan, Vasubandhu, now proud of the fame he had acquired, clung faithfully to the Hinayana doctrine in which he was well-versed and, having no faith in the Mahayana, denied that it was the teaching of the Buddha. Vasubandhu had up to this time but little regard for the Yogacara treatises of his elder brother. He had perhaps seen the voluminous Yogacarabhumi compiled by Asanga, which may have simply repelled him by its bulk. According to Bu-ston, he is reported to have said, “Alas, Asanga, residing in the forest, has practised meditation for twelve years. Without having attained anything by this meditation, he has founded a system, so difficult and burdensome, that it can be carried only by an elephant.” Asanga heard about this attitude of his brother and feared that Vasubandhu would use his great intellectual gifts to undermine the Mahayana. By feigning illness he was able to summon his younger brother to Purusapura, where he lived. However, Xuanzang differs with some of these details and the place provided by Paramartha regarding Vasubandhu’s conversion. According to the Xiyuji the conversion of Vasubandhu took place at Ayodhya. At the rendezvous, Vasubandhu asked Asanga to explain the Mahayana teaching to him, whereupon he immediately realized the supremacy of Mahayana thought. After further study, we are told, the depth of his realization came to equal that of his brother. Deeply ashamed of his former abuse of the Mahayana, Vasubandhu wanted to cut out his tongue, but refrained from doing so when Asanga told him to use it for the cause of Mahayana. Vasubandhu regarded the study of the enormous Shatasahasrikaprajna-paramita-sutra as of utmost importance. In view of the fact that they were the texts that converted him to Mahayana, Vasubandhu’s commentaries on the Akshayamatinirdesha-sutra and the Dasha-bhumika may have been his earliest Mahayana works. These were followed by a series of commentaries on other Mahayana sutras and treatises, including the Avatamsakasutra, Nirvanasutra, Vimalakirtinirdeshasutra, and Shrimaladevisutra. He himself composed a treatise on vijnaptimatra (cognition only) theory and commented on the Mahayanasamgraha, Triratna-gotra, Amrita-mukha, and other Mahayana treatises. According to the Tibetan biographers, his favorite sutra was either the Shatasahasrikaprajna-paramita-sutra or the Ashtasahasrika. Considering that these texts reveal the most profound insights into Mahayana thinking, it is not surprising that Vasubandhu liked them. Since the output of Vasubandhu’s Mahayana works is huge, he was in all probability writing new treatises every year. According to Posou pandou fashi zhuan Vasubandhu engaged in his literary activity on behalf of the Mahayana after Asanga’s death. Xuanzang, however, tells a strange story that suggests that Vasubandhu died before Asanga.

4. Intellectual Debates

With the composition of the Abhidharmakosha, Vasubandhu came to enjoy the patronage and favor of two Gupta rulers, Vikramaditya and his heir Baladitya, who can be identified respectively, as Skandagupta (ruled circa 455-467 C.E.) and Narasimhagupta (ruled circa 467-473 C.E.). The first important intellectual debate which Vasubandhu had was with Vasurata. Vasurata was a grammarian and the husband of the younger sister of Baladitya. It was Baladitya who had challenged Vasubandhu to a debate. Vasubandhu was able to defeat him successfully. Another well-known intellectual encounter which Vasubandhu had was with Samkhyas. While Vasubandhu was away, his old master Buddhamitra was defeated in a debate at Ayodhya by Vindhyavasin. When Vasubandhu came to know of it, he was enraged and subsequently trounced the Samkhyas both in debate and in a treatise the Paramarthasaptatika. Candragupta II rewarded him with 300,000 gold coins for his victory over the Samkhyas. Vasubandhu made use of this money to build three monasteries, one for the Mahayanists, another one for his old colleagues the Sarvastivadins, and a third for nuns. Refutation of Vaisheshika and Samkhya theories had been presented by Vasubandhu already in the Abhidharmakosha, but it was perhaps from this point onward that Vasubandhu was regarded as a philosopher whose views could not be lightly challenged. Samghabhadra, a Sarvastivada scholar from Kashmir, also once challenged Vasubandhu regarding the Abhidharmakosha. He composed two treatises, one consisting of 10,000 verses and another of 120,000 verses. According to Xuanzang, it took twelve years for Samghabhadra to finish the two works. He challenged Vasubandhu to a debate, but Vasubandhu refused, saying, “I am already old, so I will let you say what you wish. Long ago, this work of mine destroyed the Vaibhashika (that is, the Sarvastivada) doctrines. There is no need now of confronting you… Wise men will know which of us is right and which one is wrong.”

5. Date of Vasubandhu

The date of Vasubandhu has posed a problem for historians. According to Paramartha, Vasubandhu lived 900 years after the Mahaparinirvana of the Buddha. At another place, Paramartha also mentions the figure of 1100. Xuanzang and his disciples respectively mention that Vasubandhu lived 1000 and 900 years after the Mahaparinirvana of the Buddha. Now though it is generally believed that the Mahaparinirvana of the Buddha took place within few years of 400 B.C.E., some scholars are still hesitant to accept this date. This has led to different scholars proposing different dates for Vasubandhu. Noul Pari and Shio Benkyoo give as Vasubandhu’s dates the years 270 to 350 C.E.. Steven Anacker proposes his date as 316-396 C.E., Ui Hakuju places him in the fourth century (320-400 C.E.). Takakusu Junjiroo and Kimura Taiken gave 420 to 500, Wogihara Unrai gives 390 to 470 C.E., and Hikata Ryushoo gives 400 to 480 C.E. Erich Frauwallner suggests that there were two Vasubandhus and hence two different dates. According to him Vasubandhu the elder lived between about 320 and 380 C.E. and Vasubandhu the younger between around 400 and 480 C.E. However, this hypothesis of two Vasubandhus is no longer tenable in current scholarship as many of the early Chinese documents used by Frauwallner are of spurious nature and thus, their testimony cannot be accepted.

6. Writings of Vasubandhu

Vasubandhu is said to have been the author of one thousand works, 500 in the Hinayana tradition and 500 Mahayana treatises. But only forty-seven works of Vasubandhu are extant, nine of which survive in the Sanskrit original, twenty-seven in Chinese translation, and thirty-three in Tibetan translation. The Abhidharmakosha is the most voluminous among Vasubandhu’s independent expositions. It attained the status of a primary textbook to be studied by all students of the tradition in the Northern Buddhist countries, including Tibet. As pointed out above, the Abhidharmakosha pictures the Buddhist Path to Enlightenment through the categorization and analysis of the seventy-five dharmas.

Vasubandhu’s Karmasiddhi (Establishing Karma) is a short, quasi-Hinayana treatise coloured, as is the Abhidharmakosha, by Sautrantika leanings. His Pancaskandhaprakarana (Exposition on the Five Aggregates) discusses most of the subjects taken up in the Abhidharmakosha. In cataloguing and categorization of dharmas in the Pancaskandhaprakarana the dharmas is a bit different than the Abhidharmakosha. Moreover, whereas the Abhidharmakosha talks about seventy five dharmas, not only have several dharmas been added, but many of the original seventy five have been dropped in the Pancaskandhaprakarana.

In his Karmasiddhiprakarana (Exposition on Establishing Karma), Vasubandhu challenged the views of those who held that dharmas are anything other than being momentary. The doctrine of momentariness (kshanikavada) perceived consciousness as a causal sequence of moments in which each moment is caused by its immediate predecessor. However, he felt that this theory could not explain certain categories of continuity. For instance, kshanikavada did not offer any satisfactory explanation for the re-emergence of a consciousness stream after having been interrupted in deep sleep. Similarly, continuity from one life to the next could not be explained satisfactorily by this theory. To solve such inconsistencies, Vasubandhu introduced the Yogacara notion of the alaya vijnana (storehouse consciousness). Through this concept he explained that the seed (bija) of a previous experience is stored subliminally and released into a new experience. In this way, Vasubandhu not only explained continuity between two separate moments of consciousness, but he also provided a quasi causal explanation for the functioning of karmic retribution. In other words, Vasubandhu’s alaya vijnana provided an explanation as to how an action performed at one time could produce its result at another time. This concept also did away with the necessity of a permanent atman as the doer and recipient of karma since, like a stream, it is continuously changing with new conditions from moment to moment.

From the Yogacara point of view the most important of Vasubandhu’s works are the Vimshatika (Twenty Verses), Trimshika (Thirty Verses), and Trisvabhavanirdesha (Exposition on the Three Natures). According to tradition, the Trisvabhavanirdesha was reputedly his last treatise, and his Vimshatika and Trimshika were written near the end of his life, though we have no actual evidence to support this order. Despite the fact that all these three texts are very concise and the Trisvabhavanirdesha was not even known in China (and is never read in Tibet despite being part of Tibetan canon), they form a kind of troika and represent Vasubandhu’s final accomplishment as a Yogacara-Vijnanavada teacher.

The Vimshatika is perhaps the most original and philosophically interesting treatise of Vasubandhu. Vasubandhu devotes a major portion of this text in dealing with the Realist objections against Yogacara. To the Realist position that external things must exist because they are consistently located in space as well as time, Vasubandhu responds by saying that objects also appear to have spatial and temporal qualities in dreams, whereas nothing ‘external’ is present in the dreams. This means that the appearance of cognitive objects does not require an actual object external to the consciousness cognizing it. Vasubandhu, however, points out that without the consciousness nothing whatsoever can be apprehended. Therefore, it is consciousness that is the necessary condition and not an external object. Vasubandhu does not deny that cognitive objects exist. However, what he denies is that such cognitive objects have external reference points. From the Yogacara point of view, what we believe to be external objects are actually nothing more than mental projections. Thus, whatever we think about, know, experience, or conceptualize, occurs to us only in our consciousness and nowhere else. In other words, according to Vasubandhu, cognition takes place only in consciousness and nowhere else. Thus, everything that we know is acquired through sensory experience. We are fooled by consciousness into believing that those things which we perceive and appropriate within consciousness are actually outside our cognitive sphere. To the Realist objection that subjective wishes do not determine objective realities, Vasubandhu replies that due to collective-karma groups give rise to common misperceptions. He pointed out that it is the result of a person’s own karma that determines the type of situation in which that person would be born. Thus, Vasubandhu points out that how we see things is shaped by previous experience, and since experience is inter-subjective, we gather in groups that see things the way we do. To another Realist objection that the objective world functions by determinate causal principles, Vasubandhu points out that the appearance of causal efficacy also occurs in dreams. Thus our conscious ‘dreams’ can have causal efficacy.

The Trimshika, which became the basic text of the Faxiang (Japanese Hossoo) school, is one of Vasubandhu’s most mature works. Through concise verses he sums up his doctrine of vijnapti matra (cognition only) by explaining Yogacara theories of eight-consciousnesses, three-natures and the five-step path to Enlightenment. The eight types of consciousness are the five sense consciousnesses, the empirical consciousness (mano-vijnana), a self-aggrandizing mentality (manas), and the alaya-vijnana. Vasubandhu describes and explains how each of these can be extinguished through ashraya-paravritti i.e., through the overturning of the very basis of these eight types of consciousness. This over-turning i.e., achievement of the Bodhi gradually takes place through the five-step path in a way that consciousness (vijnana) is transformed into unmediated cognition (jnana). According to the theory of three natures, there are three cognitive realms at play: the delusional cognitively constructed realm, which is intrinsically unreal; the realm of causal dependency; and the perfectional realm which is intrinsically ‘empty.’ To Vasubandhu, Buddhism is a method of cleansing the stream of consciousness from ‘contaminations’ and ‘defilements.’

The Foxinglun (Treatise on Buddha Nature) exerted great influence on Sino-Japanese Buddhism by propounding the concept of tathagata-garbha (Buddha Nature). The Vadavidhi (A Method for Argumentation) is another important text attributed to Vasubandhu. Though this text is not strictly speaking a ‘logic’ text and does not make any distinction between techniques of debate and logic as such, still its importance in the field of logic cannot be overlooked. It not only provides information on the state of Buddhist logic prior to Dignaga, but also paved the way for the revolutionary contribution of Dignaga and Dharmakirti in the field of logic. Though not many details on the meditative career of Vasubandhu are available, his Madhyantavibhagabhashya (Commentary on the Separation of the Middle from Extremes) points to his keen interest in the techniques of meditation.

Vasubandhu’s commentaries on sutras and shastras are by no means less important than the above-mentioned independent treatises. He wrote commentaries on three treatises: the Madhyantavibhaga (Discrimination between the Middle and the Extremes), Mahayanasutralamkara (Ornament of the Mahayana Sutras), and Dharmadharmatavibhaga/ Dharmadharmtavibhanga (Discrimination between Existence and Essence). All these three treatises are important texts of the Yogacara school and are ascribed to Asanga’s teacher Maitreya. Vasubandhu also composed a commentary on Asanga’s Mahayanasamgraha (Compendium of Mahayana). It is the first methodical presentation of the doctrines of Yogacara-Vijnanavada. Vasubandhu’s Sukhavativyuhasutranirdesha (Commentary on the Sukhavativyuha Sutra) is another important text. This text became a fundamental treatise of the Pure Land faith in China and Japan. The Indian Yogacara-Vijnanavada is represented in China by three schools, and the development of all these schools is credited to the works of Vasubandhu. The first of these schools, called the Dilun school (which was established in the first half of the sixth century C.E.), took his Dashabhumikasutranirdesha (Commentary on the Dashabhumika Sutra) as its basic text. The second, the Shelun school which originated in the second half of the sixth century C.E., developed around a translation of the Mahayanasamgraha done by Paramartha. The third school, known as the Faxiang school (founded by Xuanzang and his disciple Kuiji in the seventh century), adopted the Trimshika as its basic text.

Later in life, Vasubandhu went so far ahead with his contemplative exercises that he even refused to engage in a debate with his worthy opponent Samghabhadra. He died at the age of eighty. Paramartha says that he died at Ayodhya, whereas Bu-ston says that his death took place in the northern frontier countries, which he calls ‘Nepal.’ In recognition of his contribution and achievements as a Mahayana teacher, he came to be reverently called a bodhisattva in various traditions from India to China. In fact, some go to the extent of even calling him the ‘second Buddha.’ As rightly pointed out in Bu-ston, he “was possessed of the wealth (vasu of the Highest wisdom and, having propagated the Doctrine out of mercy, had become the friend (bandhu) of the living beings.”

7. References and Further Readings

Anacker, Steven. Seven Works of Vasubandhu. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1984.
Duerlinger, James. Indian Buddhist Theories of Person: Vasubandhu’s Refutation of the Theory of a Self. London: RoutledgeCurzon, 2003.
Frauwallner, Erich. On the Date of the Buddhist Master of the Law, Vasubandhu. Rome: IsMeo, 1951.
Hall, Bruce C. “The Meaning of Vijnapti in Vasubandhu’s Concept of Mind.” Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 9 (1986): 7-23.
Chimpa, Lama, and A. Chattopadhyaya, trans. Taranatha’s History of Buddhism in India. Simla: Indian Institute of Advanced Study, 1970.
Jaini, Padmanabh S. “On the Theory of Two Vasubandhus.” Bulletin of the School of Oriental and African Studies 21 (1958): 48-53.
Kaplan, Stefan. “A Holographic Alternative to a Traditional Yogacara Simile: An Analysis of Vasubandhu’s Trisvabhava Doctrine.” Eastern Buddhist 23 (1990): 56-78.
Kochumuttom, Thomas. A Buddhist Doctrine of Experience: A New Translation and Interpretation of the Works of Vasubandhu the Yogacarin. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1982.
Kritzer, Robert. “Vasubandhu on samapratyaya vijnanamam.” Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 16/1 (1993): 24-55.
Levi, Sylvain. Un systeme de philosophie bouddhique: Materiaux pour l`etude du systeme Vijnaptimatra.Paris: Bibliotheque de l`ecole des Hautes Etudes, fasc. 260, 1932.
Lusthaus, Dan. Buddhist Phenomenology: A Philosophical Investigation of Yogacara Buddhism and the Ch’eng wei shih lun. London: Curzon, 2000.
Obermiller, E., trans. The History of Buddhism in India and Tibet by Bu-Ston. 2nd rev. ed. Delhi: Sri Satguru Publications, 1986.
Poussin, Louis de la Vallee, trans. L’Abhidharmakosha de Vasubandhu. 6 vols. Bruxelles, 1971 [reprint].
Pruden, Leo, trans. Abhidharma Kosha Bhashyam. 4 vols. Berkeley: Asian Humanities Press, 1988-90.
Ryushoo, Hikata. “A Reconsideration on the Date of Vasubandhu.” Bulletin of the Faculty of the Kyushu University 4 (1956): 53-74.
Takakusu, J. “A Study of Paramartha’s Life of Vasubandhu and the Date of Vasubandhu.” Journal of the Royal Asiatic Society (1905): 33-53.
Tola, Fernando, and Carmen Dragonetti, eds. “The Trisvabhavakarika of Vasubandhu.” Journal of Indian Philosophy 11 (1983): 225-266.
Waldron, William S. The Buddhist Unconsciousness: The alaya-vijnana in the Context of Indian Buddhist Thought. London: RoutledgeCurzon, 2003.
Yamada, Isshi. “Vijnaptimatrata of Vasubandhu.” Journal of the Royal Asiatic Society (1977): 158-176.

Author Information

K. T. S. Sarao
Email: ktssarao@hotmail.com
Delhi University
India

Validity and Soundness

A deductive argument is said to be valid if and only if it takes a form that makes it impossible for the premises to be true and the conclusion nevertheless to be false. Otherwise, a deductive argument is said to be invalid.

A deductive argument is sound if and only if it is both valid, and all of its premises are actually true. Otherwise, a deductive argument is unsound.

According to the definition of a deductive argument (see the Deduction and Induction), the author of a deductive argument always intends that the premises provide the sort of justification for the conclusion whereby if the premises are true, the conclusion is guaranteed to be true as well. Loosely speaking, if the author’s process of reasoning is a good one, if the premises actually do provide this sort of justification for the conclusion, then the argument is valid.

In effect, an argument is valid if the truth of the premises logically guarantees the truth of the conclusion. The following argument is valid, because it is impossible for the premises to be true and the conclusion nevertheless to be false:

Elizabeth owns either a Honda or a Saturn.
Elizabeth does not own a Honda.
Therefore, Elizabeth owns a Saturn.

It is important to stress that the premises of an argument do not have actually to be true in order for the argument to be valid. An argument is valid if the premises and conclusion are related to each other in the right way so that if the premises were true, then the conclusion would have to be true as well. We can recognize in the above case that even if one of the premises is actually false, that if they had been true the conclusion would have been true as well. Consider, then an argument such as the following:

All toasters are items made of gold.
All items made of gold are time-travel devices.
Therefore, all toasters are time-travel devices.

Obviously, the premises in this argument are not true. It may be hard to imagine these premises being true, but it is not hard to see that if they were true, their truth would logically guarantee the conclusion’s truth.

It is easy to see that the previous example is not an example of a completely good argument. A valid argument may still have a false conclusion. When we construct our arguments, we must aim to construct one that is not only valid, but sound. A sound argument is one that is not only valid, but begins with premises that are actually true. The example given about toasters is valid, but not sound. However, the following argument is both valid and sound:

In some states, no felons are eligible voters, that is, eligible to vote.
In those states, some professional athletes are felons.
Therefore, in some states, some professional athletes are not eligible voters.

Here, not only do the premises provide the right sort of support for the conclusion, but the premises are actually true. Therefore, so is the conclusion. Although it is not part of the definition of a sound argument, because sound arguments both start out with true premises and have a form that guarantees that the conclusion must be true if the premises are, sound arguments always end with true conclusions.

It should be noted that both invalid, as well as valid but unsound, arguments can nevertheless have true conclusions. One cannot reject the conclusion of an argument simply by discovering a given argument for that conclusion to be flawed.

Whether or not the premises of an argument are true depends on their specific content. However, according to the dominant understanding among logicians, the validity or invalidity of an argument is determined entirely by its logical form. The logical form of an argument is that which remains of it when one abstracts away from the specific content of the premises and the conclusion, that is, words naming things, their properties and relations, leaving only those elements that are common to discourse and reasoning about any subject matter, that is, words such as “all,” “and,” “not,” “some,” and so forth. One can represent the logical form of an argument by replacing the specific content words with letters used as place-holders or variables.

For example, consider these two arguments:

All tigers are mammals.
No mammals are creatures with scales.
Therefore, no tigers are creatures with scales.

All spider monkeys are elephants.
No elephants are animals.
Therefore, no spider monkeys are animals.

These arguments share the same form:

All A are B;
No B are C;
Therefore, No A are C.

All arguments with this form are valid. Because they have this form, the examples above are valid. However, the first example is sound while the second is unsound, because its premises are false. Now consider:

All basketballs are round.
The Earth is round.
Therefore, the Earth is a basketball.

All popes reside at the Vatican.
John Paul II resides at the Vatican.
Therefore, John Paul II is a pope.

These arguments also have the same form:

All A’s are F;
X is F;
Therefore, X is an A.

Arguments with this form are invalid. This is easy to see with the first example. The second example may seem like a good argument because the premises and the conclusion are all true, but note that the conclusion’s truth isn’t guaranteed by the premises’ truth. It could have been possible for the premises to be true and the conclusion false. This argument is invalid, and all invalid arguments are unsound.

While it is accepted by most contemporary logicians that logical validity and invalidity is determined entirely by form, there is some dissent. Consider, for example, the following arguments:

My table is circular. Therefore, it is not square shaped.

Juan is a bachelor. Therefore, he is not married.

These arguments, at least on the surface, have the form:

x is F;
Therefore, x is not G.

Arguments of this form are not valid as a rule. However, it seems clear in these particular cases that it is, in some strong sense, impossible for the premises to be true while the conclusion is false. However, many logicians would respond to these complications in various ways. Some might insist–although this is controverisal–that these arguments actually contain implicit premises such as “Nothing is both circular and square shaped” or “All bachelors are unmarried,” which, while themselves necessary truths, nevertheless play a role in the form of these arguments. It might also be suggested, especially with the first argument, that while (even without the additional premise) there is a necessary connection between the premise and the conclusion, the sort of necessity involved is something other than “logical” necessity, and hence that this argument (in the simple form) should not be regarded as logically valid. Lastly, especially with regard to the second example, it might be suggested that because “bachelor” is defined as “adult unmarried male”, that the true logical form of the argument is the following universally valid form:

x is F and not G and H;
Therefore, x is not G.

The logical form of a statement is not always as easy to discern as one might expect. For example, statements that seem to have the same surface grammar can nevertheless differ in logical form. Take for example the two statements:

(1) Tony is a ferocious tiger.
(2) Clinton is a lame duck.

Despite their apparent similarity, only (1) has the form “x is a A that is F.” From it one can validly infer that Tony is a tiger. One cannot validly infer from (2) that Clinton is a duck. Indeed, one and the same sentence can be used in different ways in different contexts. Consider the statement:

(3) The King and Queen are visiting dignitaries.

It is not clear what the logical form of this statement is. Either there are dignitaries that the King and Queen are visiting, in which case the sentence (3) has the same logical form as “The King and Queen are playing violins,” or the King and Queen are themselves the dignitaries who are visiting from somewhere else, in which case the sentence has the same logical form as “The King and Queen are sniveling cowards.” Depending on which logical form the statement has, inferences may be valid or invalid. Consider:

The King and Queen are visiting dignitaries. Visiting dignitaries is always boring. Therefore, the King and Queen are doing something boring.

Only if the statement is given the first reading can this argument be considered to be valid.

Because of the difficulty in identifying the logical form of an argument, and the potential deviation of logical form from grammatical form in ordinary language, contemporary logicians typically make use of artificial logical languages in which logical form and grammatical form coincide. In these artificial languages, certain symbols, similar to those used in mathematics, are used to represent those elements of form analogous to ordinary English words such as “all”, “not”, “or”, “and”, and so forth. The use of an artificially constructed language makes it easier to specify a set of rules that determine whether or not a given argument is valid or invalid. Hence, the study of which deductive argument forms are valid and which are invalid is often called “formal logic” or “symbolic logic.”

In short, a deductive argument must be evaluated in two ways. First, one must ask if the premises provide support for the conclusion by examing the form of the argument. If they do, then the argument is valid. Then, one must ask whether the premises are true or false in actuality. Only if an argument passes both these tests is it sound. However, if an argument does not pass these tests, its conclusion may still be true, despite that no support for its truth is given by the argument.

Note: there are other, related, uses of these words that are found within more advanced mathematical logic. In that context, a formula (on its own) written in a logical language is said to be valid if it comes out as true (or “satisfied”) under all admissible or standard assignments of meaning to that formula within the intended semantics for the logical language. Moreover, an axiomatic logical calculus (in its entirety) is said to be sound if and only if all theorems derivable from the axioms of the logical calculus are semantically valid in the sense just described.

For a more sophisticated look at the nature of logical validity, see the articles on “Logical Consequence” in this encyclopedia. The articles on “Argument” and “Deductive and Inductive Arguments” in this encyclopedia may also be helpful.

Author Information

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Collective Intentionality

The idea that a collective could be bearer of intentional states such as belief and intention is likely to raise some eyebrows, especially in certain Anglo-American and European philosophical circles. The dominant picture in these circles is that intentionality is a feature of individual minds/brains. On the face of it, groups don’t have minds or brains. How could they have intentional states?

Despite the initial skepticism, there is a growing number of philosophers turning their attention to the issue of collective intentionality. The focus of these recent discussions has been primarily on the notions of collective intention and belief. Philosophers of action theory have been interested in collective intentions because of their interest in understanding collective or group agency. Individual intentions shape and inform individual actions. My intention guides my daily activities, structures my desires in a variety of ways, and facilitates coordination with both my future self and others around me. But we do not always act alone and it is coordination with others that raises interesting issues regarding the possibility of collective intentions. Many philosophers believe that individual intentions alone will not explain collective action and that joint action requires joint (sometimes called shared or collective in the literature) intentions. An exception to this trend is Seamus Miller who has argued that collective or joint action can be understood in terms of collective ends that are not intentions. Because his positive account of joint action does not appeal to collective intentionality, his work will not be highlighted in this article.

Interest in the notion of collective belief has been motivated, in part, by concerns over how to understand our collective belief ascriptions and the role they play in social scientific theory and everyday contexts. We often attribute beliefs, desires, and other propositional attitudes to groups like corporations. What do these ascriptions mean? Are they to be taken literally?

Instrumentalism
Summative Accounts
Non-Summative Accounts
1. Searle
2. Bratman
3. Gilbert
4. Tuomela
Internal Debates: Belief vs. Acceptance
The Role of Collective Intentionality
References and Further Reading

1. Instrumentalism

A common response to the questions that arise concerning our practice of ascribing intentional states to groups is to say that these ascriptions are mere fictions. When we say, “The Federal Reserve believes that interest rates ought to remain low,” this does not mean that the Federal Reserve literally has a belief. Rather, we are speaking metaphorically. According to this account, our ascriptions of intentional states to groups, though useful, are, strictly speaking, false.

Although this account has common-sense appeal, it has not been appealing to philosophers working in this area for a variety of reasons. First, our practice of attributing responsibility to organizations (consider, for instance, current tobacco lawsuits) seems to presuppose that organizations literally have intentional states. For we could not hold them legally and morally responsible for an action unless they intended to commit the act. Since we do not hold organizations metaphorically responsible (much to the dismay of tobacco companies), the attributions on which our ascriptions of responsibility rest should be, at least initially, considered non-metaphorical.

Further, our ascriptions of intentional states to groups have a surprising explanatory power. They allow us to predict and explain the actions of groups. Although false ascriptions could be explanatorily powerful (just as false theories are sometimes explanatorily powerful), explanatory power is prima facie evidence that our ascriptions are not simply false. We might also note that if the instrumentalist about collective intentionality is correct, then we, the media, social scientists, lawyers, political scientists, etc. are continually disseminating falsehoods. This seems to be an odd result and again, prima facie, evidence that our ascriptions are not mere metaphors.

It should be noted that rejection of the metaphorical approach to our collective intentional state ascriptions does not necessarily commit one to the view that when we are ascribing intentional states to groups those ascriptions are true in virtue of the fact that there is a collective or group mind that is the bearer of these states. In rejecting the metaphorical approach one need not also reject an individualistic approach. As we shall see there are alternative accounts that hold that these ascriptions are true, not in virtue of there being a group mind, but in virtue of the fact that the individuals within the group have certain intentional states. Summative accounts are of this kind.

2. Summative Accounts

Summative accounts of collective attitude ascription argue that these ascriptions are a short-hand way of referring to the fact that most members have the attitude (and the content) ascribed to the group. This is the view espoused by Anthony Quinton in ‘Social Objects’ (1975). These accounts have been labeled summative by Margaret Gilbert (1989) because they try to analyze group attitude ascriptions in terms of the sum of individual attitudes with the same content as that ascribed to the group.

There are a variety of summative accounts on offer. For the purposes of this article I will focus on two types, simple summative account (SSA) and the complex summative account (CSA), identified by Margaret Gilbert in her (1987) article “Modelling Collective Belief.” According to the simple summative account:

Group G believes that p if and only if all or most of the members believe that p.

A simple summative account of group intention would substitute ‘intends’ in the formulation above. Gilbert (1987, 1989, 1994) has argued persuasively that this analysis is insufficient. Consider a case in which every member of the philosophy department believes that eating meat is immoral, but the members do not express this opinion because they are afraid of the response they will receive from their colleagues and students. In this context, it is unlikely that we would attribute to the philosophy department the belief that eating meat is immoral. It is possible, of course, to construct a context in which it would be appropriate to attribute such a belief to the philosophy department–perhaps, if the philosophy department were engaged in a discussion of animal rights. But in such a context the beliefs of the individuals would no longer be secret. Presumably, at least some of the members would express their opinions.

This example suggests that group belief depends on certain epistemic features of individuals. The complex summative account acknowledges these epistemic features by introducing the notion of common knowledge. CSA requires that members of the group recognize or know that most of the members in the group believe that p. Thus, CSA is committed to the conceptual truth of the following:

A group G believes that p if and only if (1) most of the members of G believe that p, and (2) it is common knowledge in G that (1).

Gilbert (1989, 1994) has argued that the CSA is too weak. Consider the following example: A company has formed two committees and coincidently the committees have the same exact membership. One committee has been formed in order to develop an office dress code. Call this committee the Dress Code committee. The other committee has been formed to assess the recently installed phone system. Call this committee the Phone committee. Now imagine that (a) every member of the Dress Code committee personally believes that spandex pants are inappropriate apparel for the office and this is common knowledge within the Dress Code committee, and (b) the same goes mutatis mutandis for each member of the Phone committee. It seems compatible with (a) and (b) that (c) the Dress Code committee believes spandex is inappropriate, and (d) the Phone committee does not believe that spandex is appropriate office apparel. Yet the conditions of the CSA have been met for both. Gilbert provides a similar example in (1996, 199). The addition of common knowledge, according to Gilbert, does not provide sufficient conditions for group belief. Although Angelo Corlett (1996) has criticized examples of this sort and has provided a defense of a simple summative account, most theorists agree with Gilbert that the account is insufficient.

In addition to being too weak, many including Gilbert believe that both the CSA and SSA are too strong. On summative accounts it is conceptually necessary for most of the members of G to believe that p in order for G to believe that p. This seems too strong. Indeed, there seem to be contexts in which no group member has the attitude ascribed to the group. Imagine a group of politicians who do not personally believe that partial birth abortion should be outlawed, but because of the pressure exerted by their constituents they vote to ban partial birth abortion. Ascriptions of belief to the group of politicians would probably be made on the basis of this vote and, thus, we would ascribe the belief that partial birth abortion should be banned to the group of politicians even though no individual politician personally believes this proposition.

Group intentions, too, are not easily understood in terms of the summation of individual intentions to perform some action. Consider this example given by John Searle (1990, 403). Imagine a group of people sitting on the grass enjoying a sunny afternoon. Suddenly it grows dark and starts to rain. They all get up and run for shelter. In this scenario each individual has the intention “I am running to shelter” and these intentions are had independently of one another. Now imagine a situation in which their running to the shelter is part of a performance. Suppose they are a group of actors and this is part of a scene in a play. Thus, at one point in the play they perform the same actions done by the individuals in the above scenario. According to Searle, the performance by the actors involves a collective intention in the form “we intend to do x.” This collective intention is different from the individual intentions had by the individual actors and it is not captured by summing up individual intentions in the form “I intend to x.”

The reason why collective intentions cannot be reduced to individual intentions, argues Searle, is that no set of I-intentions even supplemented with mutual beliefs will add up to a we-intend. Collective intentions involve a sense of acting and willing something together. Individual intentions involved in this enterprise are derived from collective intentions and the individual intentions that are derived from the collective intention will often have a different content from that of the collective intention. Michael Bratman (1999,111) also stresses the inadequacy of summative accounts of group intentions. Consider a case in which you have an intention to paint the house and I have an intention to paint the same house and this is common knowledge between us. The set of intentional states is not enough to guarantee that our actions are coordinated in any manner so that we are painting the house together. Indeed, the complex summative account does not rule out the possibility of our painting the same house at the same time but independent of one another (avoiding the other by chance). The set of individual intentional states identified by the complex summative accounts is not going to play any role in coordinating our behavior so that painting the house is something we do together. Intentions, either collective or individual, do, by their nature, play a role in planning and coordination. (Bratman, 1999, 1987) So, according to this line of reasoning, summative accounts, even of the complex kind, cannot be an adequate account of the nature of collective intention.

3. Non-Summative Accounts

a. Searle

In “Collective Intentions and Actions” (1990) and in The Construction of Social Reality (1995) John Searle defends an account of collective intentionality that is non-summative, but remains individualistic. Searle specifies that anything we say about collective intention must meet the following conditions of adequacy:

It must be consistent with the fact that society is nothing over and above the individuals that comprise it. All consciousness and intentionality is in the minds of individuals. Specifically, individual brains.
It must be consistent with the fact that all intentionality could be had by a brain in a vat.

Searle’s first criterion of adequacy denies that groups themselves can be intentional agents and advocates a form of individualism. The second criterion is motivated by atomism. According to this condition, all intentionality, individual or collective, is independent of what the real world is like, since a radical mistake is possible. These two conditions entail that collective intentions exist in individual brains. Thus Searle’s position allows for the possibility of a single person having the collective intention “we intend to do x.”

…I could have all the intentionality I do have even if I am radically mistaken, even if the apparent presence and cooperation of other people is an illusion, even if I am suffering a total hallucination, even if I am a brain in a vat. (1990, 117)

How is it possible for an individual to have an intention of the form “We intend to J”? Searle contends that this capacity is biologically primitive. Indeed, he suggests that it is shared by a variety of other species. This capacity presupposes other Background capacities (the Background is a technical term for Searle referring to conditions necessary for certain cognitive activities and language). In particular, it presupposes a Background sense of the other as a candidate for cooperative agency (1990, 414).

Collective intentionality plays a large role in Searle’s overall account of social reality. In The Construction of Social Reality (1995) collective intentionality is that which confers a function on artifacts and changes them into social facts. Pieces of paper function as money because we intend them to do so. Just as individual intentionality has the ability to change the world via speech acts, collective intentionality has, according to Searle, the ability to create social facts.

Searle’s account of collective intention has been criticized for a variety of reasons. First, Tollefsen (2002d) notes that it rests on the controversial assumption that externalist theories of content individuation are false. According to standard externalist reasoning, if a brain in a vat is not in the proper water environment (either in causal contact with water or able to theorize about water) then it cannot have beliefs or intentions about water. The content of a belief is determined by external rather than merely internal aspects. If this is correct then a brain in a vat could not have we-intentions. Further, there are some who argue that one could not even have a concept of another agent if he or she is not part of a social practice of interpretation (Davidson, for instance, 1992). If these views are correct it would be difficult to say how a brain in a vat could have a we-concept at all. One cannot simply assume that these theories are false without a lengthy discussion and refutation. To the extent that Searle’s account rests on a controversial thesis in the philosophy of mind and language it is problematic.

Others (Meijers 2001, Gilbert 1998) have argued that Searle’s account fails to capture the normative relations that are an integral part of collective intentions. When we form a collective intention, we create obligations and expectations among us. The football players in Searle’s example above are obligated to perform certain actions given that they have formed a collective intention to execute a pass play. As Gilbert notes (1989, 1994) if one of the players fails to do his or her part the other players have a right to rebuke their teammate. This rebuke is evidence of the normativity involved in joint action. When we form a collective intention we make commitments and incur obligations. Searle’s account, because it essentially allows for solipsistic we-intentions, fails to acknowledge the normativity involved in collective intentionality. For Gilbert and Meijers, the normativity of collective intentionality is essential to the phenomenon.

Searle himself acknowledges that it is because of the special nature of collective intentions that we are able to distinguish between the two cases of individuals running for cover in the example above. There is something about collective intentions that coordinates individual, independent actions into a joint action. But isolated, perhaps even solipsistic, we-intentions do not, in themselves, seem to be enough to direct and coordinate the individual intentional actions of which the joint action is comprised. Suppose, for instance, that none of the actors knew of the other actor’s we-intention. It would seem to be a complete accident that they acted together. Indeed, it would seem as fortuitous as a group of individuals that just happen to get up at the same time and run for cover.

b. Bratman

The problems with Searle’s account point to the fact that whatever individual intentional states underlie collective intentions, they should be interrelated in a significant way. Michael Bratman provides an account of collective intention in terms of the intentions of the individual participants and their interrelations. His analysis provides a rational reconstruction of what it is for two people to intend to do something together. We should note that Bratman uses the term “shared intention” rather than collective intention.

We need to be careful with this phrase as there are several senses in which one can “share” an intention. You and I, for instance, can both intend to wash the dishes and thus we share, in some sense, the intention to wash the dishes. But these intentions are consistent with our washing the dishes independently of one another. Here is another way to distinguish between the weak and the strong sense of sharing. You and I each have a quarter in our pockets. In this case, one might say that we share “quarter possession.” This is the weak sense of sharing. This sense of sharing is to be distinguished from a case in which we share a quarter between us. The weak sense of sharing does not aid us in understanding how people can perform actions together. With this caution in mind, I will use collective intention and shared intention interchangeably to refer to the type of intention that is thought to be crucial for understanding collective actions. The weak sense of shared intention noted above is not a candidate.

Bratman begins his discussion of collective intention by identifying the role that collective or shared intentions play. First, shared intentions help to coordinate our intentional actions. For instance, our shared intention of washing the dishes will guide each of our intentional actions towards satisfying the goal of washing the dishes. Thus, someone will wash the dishes before rinsing them and someone will rinse them before drying them. Second, our shared intention will coordinate our actions by making sure that our own personal plans of action meld together. If I plan to do the washing, then I will check with your plan and see if there is any conflict. Third, shared intentions act as a backdrop against which bargaining and negotiation occur. Conflicts about who does the washing and who does the drying will be resolved by considering the fact that we share the intention to do the dishes. Thus, shared intention unifies and coordinates individual intentional actions by tracking the goals accepted by each individual.

Consider a case in which you and I intend to wash the dishes together. If this intention is a shared intention then it is not a matter of you having an intention to wash the dishes and me having an intention to wash the dishes. Nor is it a matter of each of us having an atomistically conceived we-intention to wash the dishes. Such coincident intentions do not insure that each of us knows of the other’s intention and that we are committed to the joint action of washing the dishes together. Further, an explicit promise made to each other does not seem to insure that we share an intention either. Because I might be lying to you and have no intention of washing the dishes with you. Thus, explicit promises are not sufficient for shared intention. Nor are they necessary for shared intention. Bratman provides an example from Hume to highlight this. “Consider Hume’s example of two people in a row boat who row together ‘tho they have never given promises to each other.’ Such rowers may well have a shared intention to row the boat together”(Bratman, 1993, 98-99).

What do shared intentions consist in according to Bratman? Bratman shares Searle’s commitment to individualism in that he does not think that shared intentions are the intentions of a plural agent, nor are they to be understood solely in terms of individual intentional states. Shared intentions, according to Bratman, are to be identified with the state of affairs consisting of a set of interrelated individual intentional states. What set of individual attitudes are interrelated in appropriate ways such that the complex consisting of such attitudes would, if functioning properly, do the jobs of shared intention?

Here is a somewhat simplified version of Bratman’s answer to this question. We intend to wash the dishes if and only if:

a. I intend that we wash the dishes.
b. You intend that we wash the dishes.
I intend that we wash the dishes in accordance with and because of 1a and 1b; you intend likewise.
1 and 2 are common knowledge between us.

It should be noted that the focus in this article is on Bratman’s account of the shared intention that underlies joint intentional action. In “Shared Cooperative activity” (1999) Bratman provides an account of the shared intention that underlies more cooperative ventures and it involves conditions 1-3 and some additional conditions that rule out coercion.

As a first approximation, this complex of intentional attitudes above seems plausible. But consider a case in which we each intend to wash the dishes together and we each do so in part because of the other’s intention. However, I intend to wash the dishes with Palmolive and you intend to wash them with Joy. All of this is common knowledge and we will not compromise. Is there a collective intention present? It seems not. In this case we do not have our subplans coordinated in the appropriate way. Recall that one of the jobs that shared intention has is to coordinate our individual plans and goals. In the example above our individual subplans are in conflict and this would prevent us from achieving our goal of getting the dishes washed.

Bratman avoids this counterexample by adding a clause about participants’ subplans. It is not necessary that our subplans match, but they must mesh. So, if my subplan is to wash the dishes with Palmolive, and your subplan is to wash them with hot water, and I have no preference about the water temperature, then our subplans mesh though they don’t match exactly. But if we have subplans to wash the dishes with completely different types of dish detergent then our subplans do not mesh. Bratman reformulates the account in the following way:
We intend to J if and only if:

(a) I intend that we J and (b) you intend that we J
I intend that we J in accordance with and because of 1a and 1b, and meshing subplans of 1a and 1b; you intend the same.
1 and 2 are common knowledge

This account of collective intentions rejects the atomism of Searle’s account. Because a shared intention is the complex of attitudes of individuals and their interrelations, an individual cannot have a shared intention. As we have seen, on Searle’s account one can have a shared intention, even if one is a brain in a vat. On Bratman’s view the intentions of individuals are interrelated and reflexive in a way that makes solipsistic we-intentions impossible.

Bratman’s account of collective or shared intentions has been criticized in a variety of ways. Both Searle and Bratman attempt to avoid the specter of the collective mind. Searle places we-intentions in the mind of individuals. Bratman avoids positing a plural agent by trying to explain collective intentions in terms of individual attitudes with common contents that are distinctively social in the sense that solitary individuals could not have them. But how is it possible for me to have an intention with the form “we-intend” or with the form “I intend that we do J”? There seem to be certain features of intention itself that would rule out both Searle’s and Bratman’s ways of understanding the notion of joint intention. This line of argument has been developed, in slightly different ways, in recent papers by Annette Baier (1997), Frederick Stoutland (1997), and J. David Velleman (1997). Normally, when I intend to do something, the action I intend to do is under my control. And in normal cases of shared intention (cases where there is no coercion or where I am not in control of your actions), the other agent is seen as being in control of his or her own actions. Further, when I intend to do something, this intention settles, in some sense, what I will do. In Bratman’s terms, I have set a plan or course of action for myself. But how, then, can I intend that we do something? There is something in this scenario that is out of my control. My intention that we J cannot settle what we will do, because you have an equally important role in settling what will be done. Thus, I cannot intend that we J.

Stoutland (1997) puts the problem a bit differently by emphasizing that Bratman’s attempt to identify a set of individual intentions with common contents is impossible. Because intention makes an implicit reference to the subject that fulfills the intention, there are no intentions with common content. “Art can intend to go to a film and Mary can intend to do the same; but their intentions do not have common content, since Art’s intention is his going to the film and Mary’s is her going to the film.” (1997, 56). Likewise, it would seem impossible for me to have a Searlian we-intention. Because intention makes an implicit reference to the subject that is responsible for fulfilling the intention and I am not a we, I cannot have a we-intention. In cases of joint action I am not the subject that is responsible for fulfilling the intention. In order to be responsible I would have to have the actions of others under my direct control. But I do not. Therefore, I cannot have a we-intention.

In “I intend that we J” (1999) Bratman alters his account of shared intention in an attempt to meet this challenge. Basically, Bratman introduces the technical notion of intending that. This is supposed to be like ordinary intention except that it does not require that the individual with the intention also be the individual who fulfills the intention. I can intend that my children go to college, for instance. On this understanding of intention it seems possible for an individual to have the intention that we X. This way of avoiding the objection has seemed to some to be problematic. First, to intend that my children go to college is simply to intend to do something that brings it about that my children go to college. And these actions (whatever they might be) are under my direct control. This is not so in the case of my intending that we X. Further, Bratman seems to have changed the subject. Intentions are normally intentions to do something. It is intentions to act that explain behavior at the individual level. If collective actions presuppose intention in the way that individual agency does, then it would seem to be the same sort of intention to that is presupposed. But according to Stoutland and others, Bratman doesn’t give us an account of these intentions.

Like Searle, Bratman has been accused of ignoring the normativity of collective intentions. For Gilbert and Meijers, there is a normativity involved in collective intentionality that suggests that collective intentions and other intentional states are essentially commitments of a sort. Consider Gilbert’s (1989) example of walking together. We form an intention to walk together and begin our journey. Halfway through the walk you veer off to the left and start walking away from me. If we intended to walk together, this behavior is not only odd but justifiably subject to rebuke. The behavior will be considered to be a violation of some sort of commitment that we made. There seems to be a sense in which you ought not to have done this and I have the right to rebuke you. “Hey” I can say, “we are walking together. Where are you going?” I can take offense at your behavior and, according to Gilbert, my offense is justified and its justification derives from the normative commitments that are inherent in the collective intention.

Bratman’s account of collective or shared intentionality does not involve a normative element. For him, cognitive attitudes and their interrelations are enough to explain collective intentionality. Although he admits that certain shared activities will involve obligations, he stresses that it is possible to have a shared intention that does not involve promises or obligations. That is, there is nothing essentially normative about collective intentionality. He does, however, make a further distinction between weak and strong shared intentions, in which the latter involves binding agreement. This normativity inherent in a binding agreement, however, is explained in terms of additional moral principles like Scanlon’s (1998) “principle of fidelity.”

c. Gilbert

Margaret Gilbert’s account of collective intentions and other intentional states like belief aims, in part, to explain the nature of this normative phenomenon without having to postulate additional normative principles. Her account of collective intentionality is also part of a larger project to provide a conceptual analysis of certain group concepts. In On Social Facts (1989), in addition to providing an analysis of the concept of a group belief and intention, she also provides an account of the concept of a social group and the concept of social convention. In doing so, she claims to be uncovering the “core” of such concepts and legitimizing the use of these “everyday” concepts within the social sciences.

Gilbert’s account of collective intentionality is closely linked to her account of the concept of a social group. Briefly, our everyday concept of a social group is, according to Gilbert, the concept of a plural subject of belief or action. A plural subject is an entity, or as Gilbert puts it, “a special kind of thing, a ‘synthesis sui generis‘”(1996, 268) formed when individuals bond or unite in a particular way. This “special kind of thing” can be the subject to which intentional action and psychological attributes are attributed. We can formulate the conceptually necessary and sufficient conditions for the existence of plural subjects in the following way:

Individuals A1…..An….form a plural subject of X-ing (for some action X or psychological attribute X) if and only if A1An form a joint commitment to X-ing as a body.

It will be helpful to begin by considering what is involved in a joint commitment to act as a body or as a single individual. We will then consider the plural subject framework as it applies to psychological states like belief.

A joint commitment to act as a body is a commitment made by a collection of individuals to perform some present or future action as would a single individual. Joint commitments are formed when each of a number of people expresses his or her willingness to participate in the relevant joint commitment with the others. Each person understands that only when all of the relevant people have agreed to participate in the joint commitment will the joint commitment be formed. Once every one has agreed, a pool of wills is formed and individuals are then jointly committed. Once the joint commitment is established, each individual is individually obligated to do his or her part to make it the case that he or she acts as a body.

Consider a case in which Joe’s construction company agrees to build a house for Mrs. Wilbur. The members of the company do not each individually agree to build Mrs. Wilbur a house. This would lead to the proliferation of Wilbur abodes. They each individually agree, however, to make it the case that the house is built by the construction company and express their willingness to do so on the condition that every other member do the same. This expression of willingness need not be simultaneous. The members may express their willingness over time. Nor do they need to express their willingness verbally. In many cases, silence is an adequate expression of intention. They must, however, in order for the joint commitment to come into existence, communicate in some way and at some point in time their intention to do their part in building the house as a body with others.

Because joint commitments are joint, they cannot simply be reduced to an aggregate of individual commitments. A joint commitment gives rise to certain obligations and entitlements. Members of the group have a right to expect that other members will follow through on their commitments. Sam and Tammy are entitled to expect that Joe will do his part to make it the case that the construction company builds a house for Mrs. Wilbur. If Joe is doing something to frustrate the building process, Sam and Tammy are justified in rebuking him.

A joint commitment can only be rescinded if every member party to the joint commitment agrees to rescind it. The existence of the joint commitments in the face of an individual rescinding his or her individual commitment explains why the members of the construction company have a right to rebuke Joe when he is not doing his part. If Joe says, “I’ve had enough of this mindless labor,” and walks off the site, the joint commitment remains in full force because there has been no agreement among the members to rescind the joint commitment. This does not mean, of course, that the individual commitment Joe makes cannot be broken. It does mean, however, that if he breaks his individual commitment, even for a good reason, this does not nullify the joint commitment and its associated obligations.

According to Gilbert, the obligations which arise from a joint commitment are of a special kind and they differ from other forms of obligations in the following ways: First, although each individual in the group must be “willing” to be jointly committed, this notion of willingness does not, according to Gilbert, rule out coercion. A person can be coerced into being part of a joint commitment and yet it still remains a commitment to which a person is obligated. Gilbert wants to show that joint commitments arise in various environments and under various circumstances. Often joint commitments are coerced because the person who is doing the coercion needs the commitment of others in order to carry through with their actions.

A second aspect that distinguishes the obligations of a joint commitment from other types of obligation is the interdependence of the commitments makes it the case that no one member can rescind a joint commitment. For example, Al’s commitment to travel with Doris cannot be dissolved by Al changing his mind. This feature was already noted above.

Third, in becoming party to a joint commitment a person has a reason to act. It is a reason that remains whether or not his or her beliefs or external circumstances change. Joe is obligated to every other member of Joe’s construction company to act in accordance with the joint commitment to building a house. This commitment acts as a reason and, if reasons are causes, joint commitments can often explain why individuals act in particular circumstances. It is a reason that remains and will bind him to acting appropriately until the group as a whole decides to release one another from this obligation.

Finally, the people party to a joint commitment are aware of the obligations they have to one another. They could not be held responsible for violation of such obligations unless they were aware of these obligations. The fact that every other member has committed herself to the joint commitment is common knowledge, and there is also common knowledge of the obligations, expectations, and entitlements that arise from such commitments.

Having discussed the notion of forming a joint commitment to act as a body, we are now in a position to apply the plural subject schema to belief:

Individuals A1…An… form a plural subject of believing that p if and only if A1…An form a joint commitment to believe that p as a body.

Recall that joint commitments are commitments of groups, not individuals. They arise, in the case of joint action, when each individual expresses his willingness to do his part provided that every other individual commits to doing her part to bring it about that they perform some action as a body. Gilbert simply extends this analysis of joint action to group belief. Individuals express their willingness to do their part to make the case that they believe as a body. These commitments and expectations are common knowledge. This set of reciprocal intentions and commitments sets up the pool of wills and certain obligations and entitlements then come into play. But what is required in doing one’s part to make it the case that they believe that p as a body?

Gilbert makes it clear that members do not have to themselves believe that p. This allows her to avoid the pitfalls of the summative accounts. They also do not have to act as if they personally believe that p. Doing one’s part in the context of a joint belief, then, seems to involve at least not saying anything contrary to the group belief while speaking as a member of the group or acting contrary to the group belief while acting in one’s capacity as a group member. One who participates in a joint commitment to believe that p thereby accepts an obligation to do what he can to bring it about that any joint endeavors among the members of the group be conducted on the assumption that p is true. He is entitled to expect others’ support in bringing this about. Further, if one does believe something that is inconsistent with p, one is required at least not to express that belief baldly. The committee members would have a right to rebuke one of their own if, in acting as a member of the committee, he or she expressed views that were contrary to the group view without prefacing his or her remarks with “I personally believe that…”

According to Gilbert, then, when individuals form a plural subject of belief, (i.e., when they become party to a joint commitment to believe that p as a body), there is group belief that p. Note that she provides necessary and sufficient conditions for the existence of a plural subject of belief. But Gilbert recognizes in later work (1994) that there may be cases in which we want to say that a group has a belief, yet they do not meet the existence conditions for a plural subject of belief. This recognition leads her to say that what she is giving is an analysis of the core notion of group belief and that other cases of group belief will be extensions of this core notion. Thus, we end up with the following statement of the conceptually sufficient conditions for group belief:

There is a group belief that p if some persons constitute the plural subject of a belief that p. Such persons collectively believe that p.

Unique to Gilbert’s account is the assertion that under certain circumstances individuals form a plural subject and this subject is the legitimate subject of intentional state ascriptions. Recall that Bratman and Searle deny that there is a collective entity that is the appropriate subject of intentional state ascription. Her account, then, is less individualistic than Searle’s and Bratman’s.

Gilbert’s account of collective intentionality has been criticized on the following grounds. First, Tollefsen (2002) has argued that Gilbert’s analysis is circular. This can be seen if we consider what it means to commit to doing one’s part to make it the case that the group believe as a body or act as a body. Gilbert claims that the notion of a group of individuals acting together to constitute a body is primitive and it guides the actions and thoughts of individuals in the group. It is this notion that tells them what their part is and what they are committed to doing. It is from this concept, for instance, that one knows that she must not say p, without prefacing her remarks appropriately, when she is acting as member of a group that believes not p. To do so would be to disrupt the unity within the group and break their semblance of being “one body.”

But this notion seems to be just the notion of a plural subject. For a collection of individuals to believe as a body or act as a body is for them to act or believe as a subject, a subject constituted by a plurality of individuals. Indeed Gilbert says as much in the following passage:

I do, of course, posit a mechanism for the construction of social groups (plural subjects of belief or action). And this mechanism can only work if everyone involved has a grasp of a subtle conceptual scheme, the conceptual scheme of plural subjects. Given that all have this concept, then the basic means for bringing plural subject-hood into being is at their disposal. All that anyone has to do is to openly manifest his willingness to be part of a plural subject of some particular attribute (1989, 416)

Plural subjects are formed when each of a set of individual agents expresses willingness to constitute, with the others, the plural subject of a goal, belief, principle of action, or other such thing, in conditions of common knowledge. The conceptually necessary conditions for plural subjecthood, then, contain the notion of plural subjecthood. As a conceptual analysis of our core notion of group belief -the belief of a plural subject-Gilbert’s analysis seems circular.

Gilbert (in correspondence) has responded to this charge by arguing that for her the concept of a plural subject is a technical notion. It is not, as Tollefsen suggests, simply the notion of a subject comprised of individuals but of a subject formed on the basis of joint commitments. So her analysis of plural subjecthood does not contain the technical notion of a plural subject and her analysis is not circular. The passage above, however, suggests that, at the very least, the formation of plural subjects presupposes that the participants have an understanding of the technical concept of plural subjecthood and an understanding of joint commitments. Since both notions are very technical, it seems psychologically implausible that everyday folk have even an implicit understanding of these concepts.

Tuomela (1992) charges Gilbert with circularity, as well. Gilbert argues that joint commitments are to be analyzed in terms of individuals expressing their willingness to be jointly committed with others. But this analysis leave the concept of joint commitment unanalyzed. Gilbert does, however, say a great deal more about the notion of joint commitment than this suggests. In particular, her most recent work (2003) provides a more detailed explanation of joint commitment. Expressions of willingness come in as conditions for the formation of a joint commitment, not part of an analysis of the notion of joint commitment. If Gilbert’s analysis of joint commitment does not appeal to the notion of a joint commitment then it seems she has avoided Tuomela’s objection.

Tuomela (1998) has also argued that Gilbert’s account is somewhat limited. Her account of group intentionality is an account of what we mean when we say “We believe that p,” where “we” is a small, unstructured group like a reading club, poetry discussion group, and committees with no formal decision method. She claims that she is giving an analysis of our core meaning of group belief. But the paradigm case of attribution of intentional states to groups seems to be those in which the subject is an organization like a corporation. This is particularly true when one reflects on our practice of praising and blaming the actions of corporations, states, governments, etc. Yet it is unclear how Gilbert’s account extends to organizations. It seems obvious that not every member of the organization (take, for instance, IBM) would have to openly express their willingness to do his or her part in bringing it about that IBM believes that profits are lower this year than last as a body in order for it to be true that IBM believe that. Does the person on the assembly line have to express his willingness to be jointly committed in the way described? It seems that not even an implicit expression of willingness (a failure to speak up) would make sense of this. To the extent that Gilbert’s account does not seem to extend to a range of other types of groups to which the intentional idiom extends, Tuomela argues that it remains inadequate.

There may be ways, however, of extending Gilbert’s analysis to account for the beliefs of large organizations. Gilbert suggests that one might explain corporate beliefs, for instance, by claiming that the core notion of group belief applies to the board of directors and there is a convention in place that makes the board’s beliefs the beliefs of the corporation. Gilbert has used the plural subject framework to provide an account of convention (1989).

d. Tuomela

Raimo Tuomela (1992, 1995) develops an account of collective belief, he calls the positional account of group beliefs. This account relies on the notions of rule-based social positions and tasks that are defined by the rules in force in a collective and emphasizes the role of positional beliefs. “Positional beliefs are views that a position-holder has qua a position-holder or has internalized and accepted as a basis of his performances of aforementioned kinds of social tasks” (1995, 312). Strictly speaking, positional beliefs are not beliefs at all but acceptances. His account of collective belief attempts to encompass not only the beliefs of small, organized, groups but organizations as well. Tuomela also provides an analysis of shared we-beliefs (called non-normative or merely factual group beliefs). Shared we-beliefs are not, according to Tuomela, proper group (collective) beliefs. Collective belief does not require that any particular member actually believe that p. Whereas in the case of a we-belief each member believes that p and it is common knowledge that each member believes that p. In this respect shared we-beliefs are, according to Tuomela, those characterized by the summative accounts. They are able to capture certain social phenomena but cannot explain collective belief in cases like corporations or groups where individuals do not themselves believe the proposition in question. For our purposes we will be focusing on Tuomela’s account of group (collective) belief proper.

In Chapter Seven of The Importance of Us (1995) and Group Beliefs (1992) Synthese, 91: 285-318. Raimo Tuomela provides the following analysis of our concept of collective belief.

(BG) G believes that p in the social and normative circumstances C if and only if in C there are operative members A1……An in G with respective positions P1…….Pn such that
(1) The agents A1….Am when they are performing their social tasks in their positions P1….Pm and due to their exercising the relevant authority system in G, (intentionally) jointly accept p as the view of G, and because of this exercise of the authority system they ought to continue to accept or positionally believe that p.
(2) there is a mutual belief among the operative members to the effect that (1)
(3) because of (1) the full-fledged and adequately informed non-operative members of G tend to tacitly accept-or at least ought to accept–p as members of G.
(4) there is a mutual belief in G to the effect that (3)

This account relies heavily on a distinction between operative and non-operative members, acceptance and belief, and the notion of correct social and normative circumstances. I will consider each of these features in turn.

Operative members are those members who are responsible for the group belief having the content that it does. In the case of a corporation, the board of directors may be the operative members. Whereas those who work on the assembly line or in the credit department, for instance, are non-operative members. Which members are operative is determined by the rules and regulations of the corporation. Such rules and regulations are part of the social and normative circumstances referred to in Tuomela’s analysis.

The relevant social and normative circumstances involve tasks and social roles and rules, either formal (resembling laws or statutes) or informal (based on informal group agreements). So, for instance, corporations have certain rules that define the roles and tasks of its members. The rules are formal in some cases and are to be found in the corporate handbook or charter. These rules often specify which members are operative and define the relation between operative members and non-operative members. In addition, they make clear the chain of authority and decision-making procedures. “Indeed, in the case of typical formal collectives (like corporations), certain position-holders are required by the constitutive rules of the collective to set goals and accepts views for the collective” (1998, 308).

According to Tuomela’s analysis, then, one of the necessary conditions for our concept of group belief to apply is that operative members have certain intentional states. In this respect he shares something with Gilbert’s view and individualism in general. It is a further question whether Tuomela’s account can be viewed as intentionalistic and, if so, whether his analysis suffers from circularity. I consider this issue below. For now we can note that, for Tuomela, the intentional states of individuals must be embedded in the right social and normative circumstances. So group belief statements are not analyzed solely in terms of statements about individual intentional states on Tuomela’s view. Tuomela therefore breaks from strong analytical individualism.

Tuomela’s account also relies on the distinction between accepting a proposition and believing it. Tuomela stresses the difference between accepting and believing by noting that accepting is an action where certain beliefs are “non-actional” or experiential. Perceptual beliefs seem to be of this kind. The agent is in some way passive. He concludes based on this that at least experiential believing is different from accepting a proposition. As for non-perceptual beliefs, Tuomela goes on to argue that they are also different from accepting a proposition. Typically, when someone is said to believe that p, she does so if and only if she accepts p as true (given a certain disquotational account of truth). Tuomela points out, however, that this need not always be the case. Someone might accept a proposition but not believe it. “A person may, for instance, accept as true that he (or his body) is a probabilistically fluctuating bunch of hadrons and leptons without really believing it to be true in the experiential sense, let alone having that conviction. His acceptance would then be “cognitive” acceptance in the sense that he would be willing to operate on the assumption in question, to concretely act on it and to use it as a premise in his reasoning, and so on.” (1995, 309)

As we have seen, traditional summative accounts that require all or some of the members believe that p were too strong. Tuomela attempts to avoid this problem by requiring that operative members accept that p. No member actually has to believe that p. The operative members have, in Tuomela’s view, positional beliefs. Positional beliefs are views a position-holder has accepted as a basis for his performance of certain kinds of social tasks. These positional beliefs are different from personal beliefs. For instance, the board of directors might personally believe that it is wrong for the company to fire 10,000 employees yet a director accepts this proposition and acts on it given the fact that he holds a position of authority in the company. Positional views, then, need not be truth-related. We may accept false beliefs and therefore adopt positional views that we know to be false.

Tollefsen (2002) has argued that Tuomela’s account suffers from the same problem of circularity from which Gilbert’s account suffers. Consider condition (1) of Tuomela’s analysis.

(1) The agents A1….Am when they are performing their social tasks in their positions P1….Pm, and due to their exercising the relevant authority system in G, (intentionally) jointly accept p as the view of G, and because of this exercise of the authority system they ought to continue to accept or positionally believe that p.

The operative members must intentionally and jointly accept P as the view of the group, where joint acceptance simply means that each operative member accepts p as the view of the group and this is common knowledge. But what are we to make of the reference to “the view of the group”? On an ordinary understanding of what it is to have a view on some issue is to have an opinion or a belief. The “view” of the group, then, seems to be simply the belief of the group. If so, one of the necessary and sufficient conditions for group belief appears to make reference to the notion of a group belief. Tuomela’s analysis, then, is circular. There is a group belief that p if and only if operative members accept p as the group belief. But group belief (the view of the group rather than the view of its individual members) is the concept that the analysis is supposed to illuminate by providing necessary and sufficient conditions for its application. It is hard to see how to make sense of the view of the group without appealing to notions like the belief of the group, the goal of the group, what the group intends, and so on.

The circularity issues raised by Gilbert’s and Tuomela’s account might be avoided if we simply give up the methodology of conceptual analysis. Indeed, Tuomela insists that he is not engaged in conceptual analysis but is providing truth conditions for our ascriptions. Thus, although his account is circular, it is not viciously so. We can view these accounts, then, as offering us a sort of identity theory of collective intentionality. Indeed, this is how Bratman viewed his account of collective (shared) intention. Group belief and intention plays a certain role. What these theorists have done is identify a complex of interrelated intentional states of individuals that plays that role. One could, then, conclude that collective belief and/or intention is that complex of attitudes.

The problem with this approach is that one might wonder whether there might not be other ways in which these roles could be realized. Might there not be other combinations of individual attitudes and public acts and conditions, combinations that even in our world would function together in the ways that realize the roles of shared intention? The problem is analogous to type identity theories in the philosophy of mind. If mental states are multiply realized by different sorts of physical states, then type identity is false. Analogously, if collective intentional states are multiply realizable then identifying them with the complex of individual states is also problematic. Collective intentional states could plausibly be realized by a variety of different configurations of individual intentional states. Indeed, Tuomela’s voluminous work on group intentionality supports this. He provides different accounts of group intentional states depending on the particular group in question (e.g. normative vs. normative group belief). And we have also seen that Gilbert acknowledges that the conditions she identifies for group intentional states are sufficient but not necessary. This leaves open the possibility that group beliefs and other attitudes could be realized by other sets of individual intentional states. At the most, then, these accounts provide us with accounts of ways in which group attitudes can be realized but they do not provide us with an account of what group attitudes are.

We are left with the same question that plagues token-token identity theories in the philosophy of mind. The token identity thesis states that for every token instance of a mental state, there will be some token neuro-physiological event with which that token instance is identical. But what is it about these token mental states that makes them all tokens of the same type? If Sue and Eric both believe that Columbus is the capital of Ohio, then what is it that they have in common that makes their different neurophysiological states the same belief?

We can formulate the same question with respect to group intentional states. If GM and the Federal Reserve are both ascribed the belief that interest rates should be cut, what do these two groups have in common that makes it appropriate to ascribe to them the same belief? Tuomela would point to the fact that they both meet the conditions he specifies for proper group belief. But what if the members of GM meet the conditions of normative group belief and the members of the Federal Reserve Board meet the conditions for non-normative group belief? Do they share the same belief? And we are left with the further question of what is it about these particular configurations of intentional states that makes it appropriate to call them beliefs or intentions at all? Why is collective intentionality a species of intentionality? The work of Pettit (2002), Tollefsen (2002c), and Velleman (1997) attempt to fill this lacuna by showing that certain groups count as intentional agents given standard accounts of intentionality. Rather than analyze the concept of collective intentions or beliefs, these theorists have attempted to show that our everyday concept of belief and intention extends naturally to certain groups. Gilbert (2002), also, has recently attempted to flesh out the strong analogy between individual beliefs and group beliefs.

4. Internal Debates: Belief vs. Acceptance

Among those who acknowledge that collectives can be the subject of intentional state ascription, there is a debate raging over which type of intentional states are appropriately attributable to collectives. There are some, like Margaret Gilbert and Tollefsen who argue that it is appropriate to attribute to groups a wide range of intentional states including beliefs. Others, like K. Brad Wray (2002), Raimo Tuomela (2000), and Anthonie Meijers (1999), have argued that, although groups may accept a proposition, they cannot believe. The nature of belief, according to these philosophers, is such that groups cannot be believers. The latter camp has been labeled by Gilbert as the rejectionists because they reject the possibility of group belief. For ease, I refer to the former camp as the believers.

In “Collective Belief and Acceptance” (2002), Wray identifies four differences between acceptance and belief.

You can accept things that you do not believe but you cannot believe what you do not accept. (Rejection of the entailment thesis)
“Acceptance often results from a consideration of one’s goals, and thus results from adopting a policy to pursue a particular goal.” (2002, p. 7).
Belief is a disposition to feel that something is true.
Belief is involuntary, whereas acceptance is voluntary.

Wray then proceeds to show that the examples that Gilbert gives of group belief (1989), (1994), are actually instances of acceptance. Because group attitudes are formed against the background of goals, because they are formed voluntarily, and because their formation does not entail that members believe the content of the attitude, group views are more aptly described as instances of acceptance. Both Wray (2000) and Meijers (1999) develop an acceptance-based account of collective attitudes.

There have been various attempts to respond to this line of argument. Much rests on the merits of the original distinction between acceptance and belief and on exploring the analogy between groups and individuals. Tollefsen (2003b), for instance, argues that the issue of voluntarism concerning belief is not as clear cut as rejectionists make it out to be. The assertion that we cannot will to believe is an empirical assertion and not a conceptual assertion about the nature of belief. Perhaps, then, individuals cannot will to believe because of our epistemic limits, but this does not rule out the possibility that collective agents can will to believe. Gilbert (2002) has argued that rejectionists beg the question with respect to collective belief. They assume that collective belief must have all the features of individual belief in order for it to be genuine belief but this just privileges individual belief without argument. It may be that collective belief, although a species of belief, is unique in certain respects.

5. The Role of Collective Intentionality

We have already seen that some theorists focus on the role of collective intentions in organizing and coordinating collective action. And in Searle’s account of social reality, collective intentions confer status functions on artifacts and turn them into social facts. Money is money because we accept it and intend it to be. Others have explored the role that collective intentionality, either collective intentions or beliefs, plays in jurisprudence, economics, and politics, and moral theory. Gilbert (2001), for instance, argues that her account of collective intentionality provides a better account of social rules than H.L.A. Harts. Social rules are to be understood as the joint commitments of a society. This explains why we are justified in rebuking those who violate social rules. Maria Cristina Redondo (2001) argues that Searle’s account of social facts, an account grounding in collective intentionality, supports a version of legal positivism. Ota Weinberger (2001) develops the relationship between discussions of collective intentionality and the notion of the “general will” or the “will of the people.” Weinberger argues that the “general will” should be understood in terms of institutional processes that are collectively accepted within the community.

6. References and Further Reading

Bratman, M. 1987. Intentions, Plans, and Practical Reason. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Bratman, M. 1992. “Practical Reasoning and Acceptance in a Context.” Mind 101: 1-15.
Bratman, M. 1993. “Shared Intention.” Ethics 104: 97-113.
Bratman, M. 1999. Faces of Intention. Cambridge, MA: Cambridge University Press.
Cohen, L.J. 1992. An Essay on Belief and Acceptance. Oxford, U.K.: Clarendon Press.
Corlett, A. 1996. Analyzing Social Knowledge. Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
Davidson, D. 1992. The Second Person. Midwest Studies in Philosophy XVII: 255-265.
Gilbert, M. 1987. Modelling Collective Belief. Synthese, vol. 73. Reprinted in (1996). Chapter 7.
Gilbert, M. 1989. On Social Facts. New York: Routledge.
Gilbert, M. 1993. “Agreements, Coercion, and Obligation.” Ethics. 103: 679-706
Gilbert, M. 1994. “Remarks on collective belief” in Frederick Schmitt ed. Socializing Epistemology. Maryland: Rowman & Littlefield.
Gilbert, M. 1996. Living Together. Maryland: Rowman & Littlefield.
Gilbert, M. 1996. “Concerning Sociality: The Plural Subject as Paradigm” in J. Greenwood (ed.), The Mark of the Social. Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
Gilbert, M. (2000) Sociality and Responsibility. Blue Ridge Summit: Rowman and Littlefield.
Gilbert, M. 2001. “Social Rules as Plural Subject Phenomena” in Lagerspetz et. al.
Gilbert, M. 2002. “Belief and Acceptance as Features of Groups.” Protosociology, Volume 16, 35-69.
Gilbert, M. 2003. “The Structure of the Social Atom: Joint Commitment and the Foundation of Human Social Behavior” in Schmitt, F. ed. Socializing Metaphysics. Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
Hindriks, F. 2002. “Social Groups, Collective Intentionality, and Anti-Hegelian Skepticism,” in Realism in Action: Essays in the Philosophy of Social Science, Matti Sintonen, Petri Ylikoski, and Kaarlo Miller (eds.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Hindricks, F.A. (2002) “Social Ontology, Collective Intentionality, and Ockhamian Skepticism” in Meggle (2002), 125-49.
Lagerspetz, E. Heikki Ikaheimo, and Jussi Kotkavirta, eds. 2001 On the Nature of Social and Institutional Reality. Finland, SoPhi.
Lewis, D. 1969. Convention: A Philosophical Study. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Meggle, G. (ed.) (2002) Social Facts and Collective Intentionality, Frankfurt am Main: Hansel-Hohenhausen.
Meijers, A. (1994). Speech Acts, Communication, and Collective Intentionality:Beyond Searle’s Individualism. Leiden.
Meijers, A. (1999) Belief, Cognition, and the Will. Tilburg: Tilburg University Press, 59-71.
Meijers, A. (2003) “Can Collective Intentionality be Individualized?” American Journal of Economics and Sociology 62, 167-93.
Miller, S. 2001. Social Action, Cambridge University Press.
Pettit, P. (2003) “Groups with Minds of their Own” in Schmitt F. (ed) Socializing Metaphysics, Rowman and Littlefield, pp. 167-93.
Quinton, A. 1975. “Social Objects.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 75: 67-87.
Redondo, M. 2001. “On Normativity in Legal Contexts,” in Lagerspetz et al.
Scanlon, T. 1998. What We Owe to Each Other. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Schmitt, F. (ed). 2003. Socializing Metaphysics. Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
Searle, J. 1990. “Collective Intentions and Actions.” In Intentions in Communication, P.Cohen, J. Morgan, and M.E. Pollack, eds. Cambridge, MA: Bradford Books, MIT press.
Searle, J. 1995. The Construction of Social Reality. New York, N.Y.: Free Press.
Stoutland, F. 1997. “Why Are Philosophers of Action so Anti-Social?” in Alanen, Heinamaa, and Wallgreen eds. Commonality and Particularity in Ethics. New York, N.Y.: St. Martin’s Press.
Tollefsen, D. 2002. “Collective Intentionality and the Social Sciences.” Philosophy of the Social Sciences 32 (1): 25-50.
Tollefsen, D. 2002b. “Challenging Epistemic Individualism.” Protosociology, volume 16, pp. 86-117. June 2002.
Tollefsen, D. 2002c. “Organizations as True Believers.” Journal of Social Philosophy, vol 33 (3): pp. 395-411.
Tollefsen, D. 2002d. Interpreting Organizations. Dissertation. Ohio State University.
Tollefsen, D. 2003a. “Collective Epistemic Agency.” Southwest Philosophy Review, vol. 20 (1), pp. 55-66.v
Tollefsen, D. 2003b. “Rejecting Rejectionism.” Protosociology, volume 18. pp. 389-408.
Tollefsen, D. 2004. “Joint Action and Joint Attention.” Under review Philosophy of the Social Sciences
Tuomela, R. 1992. Group Beliefs. Synthese 91: 285-318.
Tuomela, R. 1993. “Corporate Intention and Corporate Action.” Analyse und Kritik 15: 11-21.
Tuomela, R. 1995. The Importance of Us. Standford: Standford University Press.
Tuomela, R. 2000. Cooperation: A Philosophical Study. Philosophical Studies Series, Kluwer Academic Publishers, Dordrecht.
Tuomela, R. 2002. The Philosophy of Social Practices. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Tuomela, R. (2003). The Philosophy of Social Practices. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Tuomela, R. 2004. “We-Intention Revisted.” forthcoming in Philosophical Studies.
Velleman, D. 1997. “How to Share an Intention.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research LVII: 29-50.
Weinberger, O. 2001. “Democracy and theory of institutions,” in Lagerspetz et al.
Wray, B. 2000. “Collective Belief and Acceptance.” Synthese 00: 1-15.

Author Information

Deborah Tollefsen
Email: dtollfsn@memphis.edu
University of Memphis
U. S. A.

Special Relativity: Proper Time, Coordinate Systems, and Lorentz Transformations

This supplement to the main Time article explains some of the key concepts of the Special Theory of Relativity (STR). It shows how the predictions of STR differ from classical mechanics in the most fundamental way. Some basic mathematical knowledge is assumed.

Proper Time
The STR Relationship Between Space, Time, and Proper Time
Coordinate Systems
1. Coordinates as a Mathematical Language for Time and Space
Cartesian Coordinates for Space
Choice of Inertial Reference Frame
Operational Specification of Coordinate Systems for Classical Space and Time
Operational Specification of Coordinate Systems for STR Space and Time
Operationalism
Coordinate Transformations and Object Transformations
Valid Transformations
Velocity Boosts in STR and Classical Mechanics
Galilean Transformation of Coordinate System
Lorentz Transformation of Coordinate System
Time and Space Dilation
The Full Special Theory of Relativity
References and Further Reading

1. Proper Time

The essence of the Special Theory of Relativity (STR) is that it connects three distinct quantities to each other: space, time, and proper time. ‘Time’ is also called coordinate time or real time, to distinguish it from ‘proper time’. Proper time is also called clock time, or process time, and it is a measure of the amount of physical process that a system undergoes. For example, proper time for an ordinary mechanical clock is recorded by the number of rotations of the hands of the clock. Alternatively, we might take a gyroscope, or a freely spinning wheel, and measure the number of rotations in a given period. We could also take a chemical process with a natural rate, such as the burning of a candle, and measure the proportion of candle that is burnt over a given period.

Note that these processes are measured by ‘absolute quantities’: the number of times a wheel spins on its axis, or the proportion of candle that has burnt. These give absolute physical quantities and do not depend upon assigning any coordinate system, as does a numerical representation of space or real time. The numerical coordinate systems we use firstly require a choice of measuring units (meters and seconds, for example). Even more importantly, the measurement of space and real time in STR is relative to the choice of an inertial frame. This choice is partly arbitrary.

Our numerical representation of proper time also requires a choice of units, and we adopt the same units as we use for real time (seconds). But the choice of a coordinate system, based on an inertial frame, does not affect the measurement of proper time. We will consider the concept of coordinate systems and measuring units shortly.

Proper time can be defined in classical mechanics through cyclic processes that have natural periods – for instance, pendulum clocks are based on counting the number of swings of a pendulum. More generally, any natural process in a classical system runs through a sequence of physical states at a certain absolute rate, and this is the ‘proper time rate’ for the system.

In classical physics, two identical types of systems (with identical types of internal construction, and identical initial states) are predicted to have the same proper time rates. That is, they will run through their physical states in perfect correlation with each other.

This holds even if two identical systems are in relative constant motion with respect to each other. For instance, two identical classical clocks would run at the same rate, even if one is kept stationary in a laboratory, while the other is placed in a spaceship traveling at high speed.

This invariance principle is fundamental to classical physics, and it means that in classical physics we can define: Coordinate time = Proper time for all natural systems. For this reason, the distinction between these two concepts of time was hardly recognized in classical physics (although Newton did distinguish them conceptually, regarding ‘real time’ as an absolute temporal flow, and ‘proper time’ as merely a ‘sensible measure’ of real time; see his Scholium).

However, the distinction only gained real significance in the Special Theory of Relativity, which contradicts classical physics by predicting that the rate of proper time for a system varies with its velocity, or motion through space. The relationship is very simple: the faster a system travels through space, the slower its internal processes go. At the maximum possible speed, the speed of light, c, the internal processes in a physical system would stop completely. Indeed, for light itself, the rate of proper time is zero: there is no ‘internal process’ occurring in light. It is as if light is ‘frozen’ in a specific internal state.

At this point, we should mention that the concept of proper time appears more strongly in quantum mechanics than in classical mechanics, through the intrinsically ‘wave-like’ nature of quantum particles. In classical physics, single point-particles are simple things, and do not have any ‘internal state’ that represents proper time, but in quantum mechanics, the most fundamental particles have an intrinsic proper time, represented by an internal frequency. This is directly related to the wave-like nature of quantum particles. For radioactive systems, the rate of radioactive decay is a measure of proper time. Note that the amount of decay of a substance can be measured in an absolute sense. For light, treated as a quantum mechanical particle (the photon), the rate of proper time is zero, and this is because it has no mass. But for quantum mechanical particles with mass, there is always a finite ‘intrinsic’ proper time rate, represented by the ‘phase’ of the quantum wave. Classical particles do not have any correlate of this feature, which is responsible for quantum interference effects and other non-classical ‘wave-like’ behavior.

2. The STR Relationship Between Space, Time, and Proper Time

STR predicts that motion of a system through space is directly compensated by a decrease in real internal processes, or proper time rates. Thus, a clock will run fastest when it is stationary. If we move it about in space, its rate of internal processes will decrease, and it will run slower than an identical type of stationary clock. The relationship is precisely specified by the most profound equation of STR, usually called the metric equation (or line metric equation). The metric equation is:

(1)

This applies to the trajectory of any physical system. The quantities involved are:

D is the difference operator.

Dt is the amount of proper time elapsed between two points on the trajectory.

Dt is the amount of real time elapsed between two points on the trajectory.

Dr is the amount of motion through space between two points on the trajectory.

c is the speed of light, and depends on the units we choose for space and time.

The meaning of this equation is illustrated by considering simple trajectories depicted in a space-time diagram.

Figure 1. Two simple space-time trajectories.

If we start at a initial point on the trajectory of a physical system, and follow it to a later point, we find that the system has covered a certain amount of physical space, Dr, over a certain amount of real time, Dt, and has undergone a certain amount of internal process or proper-time, Dt. As long as we use the same units (seconds) to represent proper time and real time, these quantities are connected as described in Equation (1). Proper time intervals are shown in Figure 1 by blue dots along the trajectories. If these were trajectories of clocks, for example, then the blue dots would represent seconds ticked off by the clock mechanism.

In Figure 1, we have chosen to set the speed of light as 1. This is equivalent to using our normal units for time, i.e. seconds, but choosing the units for space as c meters (instead of 1 meter), where c is the speed of light in meters per second. This system of units is often used by physicists for convenience, and it appears to make the quantity c drop out of the equations, since c = 1. However, it is important to note that c is a dimensional constant, and even if its numerical value is set equal to 1 by choosing appropriate units, it is still logically necessary in Equation 1 for the equation to balance dimensionally. For multiplying an interval of time, Dt, by the quantity c converts from a temporal quantity into a spatial quantity. Equations of physics, just like ordinary propositions, can only identify objects or quantities of the same physical kinds with each other, and the role of c as a dimensional constant remains crucial in Equation (1), for the identity it states to make any sense.

Trajectories in Figure 1

Trajectory 1 (green) is for a stationary particle, hence Dr = 0 (it has no motion through space), and putting this value in Equation (1), we find that: Dt = Dt. For a stationary particle, the amount of proper time is equal to the amount of coordinate time.
Trajectory 2 (red) is for a moving particle, and Dr > 0. We have chosen the velocity in this example to be: v = c/2, half the speed of light. But: v = Dr/Dt (distance traveled in the interval of time). Hence: Dr = ½cDt. Putting this value into Equation (1), we get: c²Dt² = c²Dt²-(½cDt)², or: Dt = Ö(¾)Dt » 0.87Dt. Hence the amount of proper time is only about 87% of coordinate time. Even though this trajectory is very fast, proper time is still only slowed down a little.
Trajectory 3 (black) is for a particle moving at the speed of light, with v = c, giving: Dr = cDt. Putting this in Equation (1), we get: c²Dt² = c²Dt²-(cDt)² = 0. Hence for a light-like particle, the amount of proper time is equal to 0.

Now from the classical point of view, Equation (1) is a surprise – indeed, it seems bizarre! For how can mere motion through space directly and precisely affect the rate of physical processes occurring in a system? We are used to the opposite idea, that motion through space, by itself, has no intrinsic effect on processes. This is at the heart of the classical Galilean invariance or symmetry. But STR breaks this rule.

We can compare this situation with classical physics, where (for linear trajectories) we have two independent equations:

(2.a) Dt = Dt

(2.b) Dr = vDt for some (real numbers)

Equation (2.a) just means that the rate of proper time in a system is invariant – and we measure it in the same units as coordinate time, t.
Equation (2.b) just means that every particle or system has some finite velocity or speed, v, through space, with v defined by: v = Dr/Dt.

There is no connection here between proper time and spatial motion of the system.

The fact that (2) is replaced by (1) in STR is very peculiar indeed. It means that the rate of internal process in a system like a clock (whether it is a mechanical, chemical, or radioactive clock) is automatically connected to the motion of the clock in space. If we speed up a clock in motion through space, the rate of internal process slows down in a precise way to compensate for the motion through space.

The great mystery is that there is no apparent mechanism for this effect, called time dilation. In classical physics, to slow down a clock, we have to apply some force like friction to its internal mechanism. In STR, the physical process of a system is slowed down just by moving it around. This applies equally to all physical processes. For instance, a radioactive isotope decays more slowly at high speed. And even animals, including human beings, should age more slowly if they move around at high speed, giving rise to the Twin Paradox.

In fact, time dilation was already recognized by Lorentz and Poincare, who developed most of the essential mathematical relationships of STR before Einstein. But Einstein formulated a more comprehensive theory, and, with important contributions by Minkowski, he provided an explanation for the effects. The Einstein-Minkowski explanation appeals to the new concept of a space-time manifold, and interprets Equation (1) as a kind of ‘geometric’ feature of space-time. This view has been widely embraced in 20th Century physics. By contrast, Lorentz refused to believe in the ‘geometric’ explanation, and he thought that motion through space has some kind of ‘mechanical’ effect on particles, which causes processes to slow down. While Lorentz’s view is dismissed by most physicists, some writers have persisted with similar ideas, and the issues involved in the explanation of Equation (1) continue to be of deep interest, to philosophers at least.

But before moving on to the explanation, we need to discuss the concepts of coordinate systems for space and time, which we have been assuming so far without explanation.

3. Coordinate Systems

In physics we generally assume that space is a three dimensional manifold and time is a one dimensional continuum. A coordinate system is a way of representing space and time using numbers to represent points. We assign a set of three numbers, (x,y,z), to characterize points in space, and one number, t, to characterize a point in time. Combining these, we have general space-time coordinates: (x,y,z,t). The idea is that every physical event in the universe has a ‘space-time location’, and a coordinate system provides a numerical description of the system of these possible ‘locations’.

Classical coordinate systems were used by Descartes, Galileo, Newton, Leibniz, and other classical physicists to describe space. Classical space is assumed to be a three dimensional Euclidean manifold. Classical physicists added time coordinates, t, as an additional parameter to characterize events. The principles behind coordinate systems seemed very intuitive and natural up until the beginning of the 20th century, but things changed dramatically with the STR. One of Einstein’s first great achievements was to reexamine the concept of a coordinate system, and to propose a new system suited to STR, which differs from the system for classical physics. In doing this, Einstein recognized that the notion of a coordinate system is theory dependent. The classical system depends on adopting certain physical assumptions of classical physics – for instance, that clocks do not alter their rates when they are moved about in space. In STR, some of the laws underpinning these classical assumptions change, and this changes our very assumptions about how we can measure space and time. To formulate STR successfully, Einstein could not simply propose a new set of physical laws within the existing classical framework of ideas about space and time: he had to simultaneously reformulate the representation of space and time. He did this primarily by reformulating the rules for assigning coordinate systems for space and time. He gave a new system of rules suited to the new physical principles of STR, and reexamined the validity of the old rules of classical physics within this new system.

A key feature Einstein focused on is that a coordinate system involves a system of operational principles, which connect the features of space and time with physical processes or ‘operations’ that we can use to measure those features. For instance, the theory of classical space assumes that there is an intrinsic distance (or length) between points of space. We may take distance itself to be an underlying feature of ‘empty space’. Geometric lines can be defined as collections of points in space, and line segments have intrinsic lengths, prior to any physical objects being placed in space. But of course, we only measure (or perceive) the underlying structure of space by using physical objects or physical processes to make measurements. Typically, we use ‘straight rigid rulers’ to measure distances between points of space; or we use ‘uniform, standard clocks’ to measure the time intervals between moments of time. Rulers and clocks are particular physical objects or processes, and for them to perform their measurement functions adequately, they must have appropriate physical properties.

But those physical properties are the subject of the theories of physics themselves. Classical physics, for example, assumes that ordinary rigid rulers maintain the same length (or distance between the end-points) when they are moved around in space. It also assumes that there are certain types of systems (providing ‘idealized clocks’) that produce cyclic physical processes, and maintain the same temporal intervals between cycles through time, even if we move these systems around in space.

These assumptions are internally consistent with principles of measurement in classical physics. But they are contradicted in STR, and Einstein had to reformulate the operational principles for measuring space and time, in a way that is internally consistent with the new physical principles of STR.

We will briefly describe these new operational principles shortly, but there are some features of coordinate systems that are important to appreciate first.

a. Coordinates as a Mathematical Language for Time and Space

The assignment of a numerical coordinate system for time or space is thought of as providing a mathematical language (using numbers as names) for representing physical things (time and space). In a sense, this language could be ‘arbitrarily chosen’: there are no laws about what names can be used to represent things. But naturally there are features that we want a coordinate system to reflect. In particular, we want the assignment of numbers to directly reflect the concepts of distance between points of space, and the size of intervals between moments of time.

We perform mathematical operations on numbers, and we can subtract two numbers to find the ‘numerical distance’ between them. For numbers are really defined as certain structures, with features such as continuity, and we want to use the structures of number systems to represent structural features of space and time.

For instance, we assume in our fundamental physical theory that any two intervals of time have intrinsic magnitudes, which can be compared to each other. The ‘intrinsic temporal distance’ between two moments, t₁ and t₂, may be the same as that between two quite different moments, t₃ and t₄. We naturally want to assign numbers to times so that ordinary numerical subtraction corresponds to the ‘intrinsic temporal distance’ between events. We choose a ‘uniform’ coordinate system for time to achieve this.

coordinate systems 4

Figure 2. A Coordinate system for time gives a mathematical language for a physical thing.
Numbers are used as names for moments of time.

4. Cartesian Coordinates for Space

Time is simple because it is one-dimensional. Three-dimensional space is much more complex. Because space is three dimensional, we need three separate real numbers to represent a single point. Physicists normally choose a Cartesian coordinate system to represent space. We represent points in this system as: r = (x,y,z), where x, y, and z are separate numerical coordinates, in three orthogonal (perpendicular) directions.

The numerical structure with real-number points is denoted in mathematics as (x,y,z). Three dimensional space itself (a physical thing) is denoted as: . A Cartesian coordinate system is a special kind of mapping between points of these two structures. It makes the intrinsic spatial distance between two points in E³ be directly reflected by the ‘numerical distance’ between their numerical coordinates in .

The numerical distances in are determined by a numerical function for length. A line from the origin: (0,0,0), to the point r = (x,y,z), which is called the vector r, has its length given by the Pythagorean formula:

|r| = √(x²+y²+z²).

More generally, for any two points, r₁ = (x₁, y₁, z₁), and: r₂ = (x₂, y₂, z₂), the distance function is:

|r₂ – r₁| = √((x₂ – x₁)²+ (y₂ – y₁)²+ (z₂ – z₁)²)

The special feature of this system is that the lengths of lines in the x, y, or z directions alone are given directly by the values of the coordinates. E.g. if: r = (x,0,0), then the vector to r is a line purely in the x-direction, and its length is simply: |r| = x. If r₁ = (x₁,0,0), and: r₂ = (x₂,0,0), then the distance between them is just: |r₂ – r₁| = (x₂ – x₁ ). As well, a Cartesian coordinate system treats the three directions, x, y, and z, in a symmetric way: the angles between any pair of these directions is the same, 90⁰. For this reason, a Cartesian system can be rotated, and the same form of the general distance function is maintained in the rotated system.

In fact, there are spatial manifolds which do not have any possible Cartesian coordinate system – e.g. the surface of a sphere, regarded as a two dimensional manifold, cannot be represented by using Cartesian coordinates. Such spaces were first studied as geometric systems in the 19th century, and are called non-classical or non-Euclidean geometries. However, classical space is Euclidean, and by definition:

Euclidean space can be represented by Cartesian coordinate systems.

We can define alternative, non-Cartesian, coordinate systems for Euclidean space; for instance, cylindrical and spherical coordinate systems are very useful in physics, and they use mixtures of linear or radial distance, and angles, as the numbers to specify points of space. The numerical formulas for distance in these coordinate systems appear quite different from the Cartesian formula. But they are defined to give the same results for the distances between physical points. This is the most crucial feature of the concept of distance in classical physics:

Distance between points in classical space (or between two events that occur at the same moment of time) is a physical invariant. It does not change with the choice of coordinate system.

The form of the numerical equation for distance changes with the choice of coordinate system; but this is done deliberately to preserve the physical concept of distance.

5. Choice of Inertial Reference Frame

A second crucial concept is the idea of a reference frame. A reference frame specifies all the trajectories that are regarded as stationary, or at rest in space. This defines the property of remaining at the same place through time. But the key feature of both classical mechanics and STR is that no unique reference frame is determined. Any object that is not accelerating can be regarded as stationary ‘in its own inertial frame’. It defines a valid reference frame for the whole universe. This is the natural reference frame ‘from the point of view’ of the object, or ‘relative to the object’. But there are many possible choices because given any particular reference frame, any other frame, defined to give everything a constant velocity relative to the first frame is also a valid choice.

The class of possible (physically valid) reference frames is objectively determined, because acceleration is absolutely distinguished from constant motion. Any object that is not accelerating may be regarded as defining a valid reference frame. But the specific choice of a reference frame from the range of possibilities is regarded as arbitrary or conventional. This choice must be made before a coordinate system can be defined to represent distances in space and time. Even after we have chosen a reference frame, there are still innumerable choices of coordinate systems. But the reference frame settles the definition of distances between events, which must be defined as the same in any coordinate system relative to a given reference frame.

The idea of the conventionality of the reference frame is partly evident already in the choice of a Cartesian coordinate system: for it is an arbitrary matter where we choose the origin, or point: 0 = (0,0,0), for such a system. It is also arbitrary which directions we choose for the x, y, and z axes – as long as we make them mutually perpendicular. We are free to rotate a given set of axes, x, y, z, to produce a new set, x’, y’, and z’, and this gives another Cartesian coordinate system. Thus, translations and rotations of Cartesian coordinate systems for space still leave us with Cartesian systems.

But there is a further transformation, which is absolutely central to classical physics, and involves both time and space. This is the Galilean velocity transformation, or velocity boost. The essential point is that we need to apply a spatial coordinate system through time. In pure classical geometry, we do not have to take time into account: we just assign a single coordinate system, at a single moment of time. But in physics we need to apply a coordinate system for space at different moments of time. How do we know whether the coordinate system we apply at one moment of time represents the same coordinate system we use at a later moment of time?

The principles of classical physics mean that we cannot measure ‘absolute location in space’ across time. The reason is the fundamental classical principle that the laws of nature do not distinguish between two inertial frames moving relative to each other at a constant speed. This is the classical Galilean principle of ‘relativity of motion’. Roughly stated, this means that uniform motion through space has no effect on physical processes. And if motion in itself does not affect processes, then we cannot use processes to detect motion.

Newton believed that the classical conception of space requires there to be absolute spatial locations through time nonetheless, and that some special coordinate systems or physical objects will indeed be at ‘absolute rest’ in space. But in the context of classical physics, it is impossible to measure whether any object is at absolute rest, or is in uniform motion in space. Because of this, Leibniz denied that classical physics requires any concept of absolute position in space, and argued that only the notion of ‘relative’ or ‘relational’ space’ is required. In this view, only the relative positions of objects with regards to each other are considered real. For Newton, the impossibility of measuring absolute space does not prevent it from being a viable concept, and even a logically necessary concept. There is still no general agreement about this debate between ‘absolute’ and ‘relative’ or ‘relational’ conceptions of space. It is one of the great historical debates in the philosophy of both classical and relativistic physics. However, it is generally accepted that classical physics makes absolute space undetectable. This means, at least, that in the context of classical physics there is no way of giving an operational procedure for determining absolute position (or absolute rest) through time.

However absolute acceleration is detectable. Accelerations are always accompanied by forces. This means that we can certainly specify the class of coordinate systems which are in uniform motion, or which do not accelerate. These special systems are called inertial systems, or inertial frames, or Galilean frames. The existence of inertial frames is a fundamental assumption of classical physics. It is also fundamental in STR, and the notion of an inertial frame is very similar in both theories.

The laws of classical physics are therefore specified for inertial coordinate systems. They are equally valid in any inertial frame. The same holds for the laws of STR. However, the laws for transforming from one inertial frame to another are different for the two theories. To see how this works, we now consider the operational specification of coordinate systems.

6. Operational Specification of Coordinate Systems for Classical Space and Time

In classical physics, we can define an ‘operational’ measuring system, which allows us to assign coordinates to events in space and time.

Classical Time. We imagine measuring time by making a number of uniform clocks, synchronizing them at some initial moment, checking that they all run at exactly the same rates (proper time rates), and then moving clocks to different points of space, where we keep them ‘stationary’ in a chosen inertial frame. We subsequently measure the times of events that occur at the various places, as recorded by the different clocks at those places.

Of course, we cannot assume that our system of clocks is truly stationary. The entire system of clocks placed in uniform motion would also define a valid inertial frame. But the laws of classical physics mean that clocks in uniform inertial motion run at exactly the same rates, and so the times recoded for specific events turn out to be exactly the same, on the assumptions of the classical theory, for any such system of clocks.

Classical Space. We imagine measuring space by constructing a set of rigid measuring rods or rulers of the same length, which we can (imaginatively at least) set up as a grid across space, in an inertial frame. We keep all the rulers stationary relative to each other, and we use them to measure the distances between various events. Again, the main complication is that we cannot determine any absolutely stationary frame for the grid of rulers, and we can set up an alternative system of rulers which is in relative motion. This results in assigning different ‘absolute velocities’ to objects, as measured in two different frames. However, on the assumptions of the classical theory, the relative distances between any two objects or events, taken at any given moment of time, is measured to be the same in any inertial frame. This is because, in classical physics, uniform motion in itself does not alter the lengths of material objects, or the forces between systems of objects. (Accelerations do alter lengths).

7. Operational Specification of Coordinate Systems for STR Space and Time

In STR, the situation is in many ways very similar to classical physics: there is still a special concept of inertial frames, acceleration is absolutely detectable, and uniform velocity is undetectable. According to STR, the laws of physics still are invariant with regard to uniform motion in space, very much like the classical laws.

We also specify operational definitions of inertial coordinate systems in STR in a similar way to classical physics. However, the system sketched above for assigning classical coordinates fails, because it is inconsistent with the physical principles of STR. Einstein was forced to reconstruct the classical system of measurement to obtain a system which is internally consistent with STR.

STR Time. In STR, we can still make uniform clocks, which run at the same rates when they are held stationary relative to each other. But now there is a problem synchronizing them at different points of space. We can start them off synchronized at a particular common point; but moving them to different points of space already upsets their synchronization, according to Equation (1).

However, while synchronizing distant clocks is a problem, they nonetheless run at the same intrinsic rates as each other when held in the same inertial frame. And we can ensure two clocks are in a common inertial frame as long as we can ensure that they maintain the same distance from each other. We see how to do this next.

Given we have two clocks maintained at the same distance from each other, Einstein showed that there is indeed a simple operational procedure to establish synchronization. We send a light signal from Clock 1 to Clock 2, and reflect it back to Clock 1. We record the time it was sent on Clock 1 as t₀, and the time it was received again as a later time, t₂. We also record the time it was received at Clock 2 as t₁’ on Clock 2. Now symmetry of the situation requires that, in the inertial frame of Clock 1, we must assume that the light signal reached Clock 2 at a moment halfway between t₀ and t₁, i.e. at the time: t₁ = ½(t₂ – t₀). This is because, by symmetry, the light signal must take equal time traveling in either direction between the clocks, given that they are kept at a constant distance throughout the process, and they do not accelerate. (If the light signal took longer to travel one way than the other, then light would have to move at different speeds in different directions, which contradicts STR).

Hence, we must resynchronize Clock 2 to make: t₁’ = t₁. We simply set the hands on Clock 2 forwards by: (t₁ – t₁’), i.e. by: ½(t₂ – t₀) – t₁’. (Hence, the coordinate time on Clock 2 at t₁’ is changed to: t₁’ + (½(t₂ – t₀) – t₁’) = ½(t₂ – t₀) = t₁.)

This is sometimes called the ‘clock synchronization convention’, and some philosophers have argued about whether it is justified. But there is no real dispute that this successfully defines the only system for assigning simultaneity in time, in the chosen reference frame, which is consistent with STR.

Some deeper issues arise over the notion of simultaneity that it seems to involve. From the point of view of Clock 1, the moment recorded at: t₁ = ½(t₂ – t₀) must be judged as ‘simultaneous’ with the moment recorded at t₁’ on Clock 2. But in a different inertial frame, the natural coordinate system will alter the apparent simultaneity of these two events, so that simultaneity itself is not ‘objective’ in STR, except relative to a choice of inertial frame. We will consider this later.

STR Space. In STR, we can measure space in a very similar way as in classical physics. We imagine constructing a set of rigid measuring rods or rulers, which are checked to be the same length in the inertial frame of Clock 1, and we extend this out into a grid across space. We have to move the rulers around to start with, but when we have set up the grid, we keep them all stationary in the chosen inertial frame of Clock 1.

We then use this grid of stationary measuring rods to measure the distances between various events. The main assumption is that identical types of measuring rods (which are the same lengths when we originally compare them at rest with Clock 1), maintain the same lengths after being moved to different places (and being made stationary again with regard to Clock 1). This feature is required by STR.

The main complication, once again, is that we cannot determine any absolutely stationary frame for the grid of rulers. We can set up an alternative system of rulers, which are all in relative motion in a different inertial frame. As in classical physics, this results in assigning different ‘absolute velocities’ to most trajectories in the two different frames. But in this case there is a deeper difference: on the assumptions of STR, the lengths of measuring rods alter according to their velocities. This is called space dilation, and it is the counterpart of time dilation.

Nonetheless, Einstein showed that perfectly sensible operational definitions of coordinate measurements for length, as well as time, are available in STR. But both simultaneity and length become relative to specified inertial frames.

It is this confusing conceptual problem, which involves the theory dependence of measurement, that Einstein first managed to unravel, as the prelude to showing how to radically reconstruct classical physics.

8. Operationalism

Unraveling this problem requires us to specify ‘operational principles’ of measurement, but this does not require us to embrace an operational theory of meaning. The latter is a form of positivism, and it holds that the meaning of ‘time’ or ‘space’ in physics is determined entirely by specifying the procedures for measuring time or space. This theory is generally rejected by philosophers and logicians, and it was rejected by Einstein himself in his mature work. According to operationalism, STR changes the meanings of the concepts of space and time from the classical conception. However, many philosophers would argue that ‘time’ and ‘space’ have a meaning for us which is essentially the same as for Galileo and Newton, because we identify the same kinds of things as time and space; but relativity theory has altered our scientific beliefs about these things – just as the discovery that water is H2O has altered our understanding of the nature of water, without necessarily altering the meaning of the term ‘water’. This semantic dispute is ongoing in the philosophy of science. Having clarified these basic ideas of coordinate systems and inertial frames, we now turn back to the notion of transformations between coordinate systems for different inertial frames.

9. Coordinate Transformations and Object Transformations

Physics uses two different concepts of transformations. It is important to distinguish these carefully.

Coordinate transformations: Taking the description of a given process (such as a trajectory), described in one coordinate system, and transforming to its description in an alternative coordinate system.
Object transformations: Taking a given process, described in a given coordinate system, and transforming it into a different process, described in the same coordinate system as the original process.

The difference is illustrated in the following diagram for the simplest kind of transformation, translation of space.

coordinate systems 6

Figure 3. Object, Coordinate, and Combined Transformations.

The transformations in Figure 3 are simple space translations.
Figure 3 (B) shows an object transformation. The original trajectory (A) is moved in space to the right, by 4 units. The new coordinates are related to the original coordinates by: x_{new particle} ® x_{original particle} + 4.
Figure 3 (C) shows a coordinate transformation: the coordinate system is moved to the left by 4 units. The new coordinate system, x’, is related to the original system, x, by: x’_{original particle} = x_{original particle} + 4. The result ‘looks’ the same as (B).
Figure 3 (D) shows a combination of the object transformation (B) and a coordinate transformation, which is the inverse of that in (C), defined by: x’’_{original particle} = x_{original particle} – 4. The result of this looks the same as the original trajectory in (A), because the coordinate transformation appears to ‘undo’ the effect of the object transformation.

10. Valid Transformations

There is an intimate connection between these two kinds of transformations. This connection provides the major conceptual apparatus of modern physics, through the concept of physical symmetries, or invariance principles, and valid transformations.

The deepest features of laws or theories of physics are reflected in their symmetry properties, which are also called invariances under symmetry transformations. Laws or theories can be understood as describing classes of physical processes. Physical processes that conform to a theory are valid physical processes of that theory. Of course, not all (logically) possible processes that we can imagine are valid physical processes of a given theory. Otherwise the theory would encompass all possible processes, and tell us nothing about what is physically possible, as opposed to what is logically conceivable.

Symmetries of a theory are described by transformations that preserve valid processes of the theory. For instance, time translation is a symmetry of almost all theories. This means that if we take a valid process, and transform it, intact, to an earlier or later time, we still have a valid process. This is equivalent to simply setting the ‘temporal origin’ of the process to a later or earlier time.

Other common symmetries are:

Rotations in space (if we take a valid process, and rotate it to another direction in space, we end up with another valid process).
Translations in space (if we take a valid process, and move it to another position in space, we end up with another valid process).
Velocity transformations (if we take a valid process, and give it uniform velocity boost in some direction in space, we end up with another valid process).

These symmetries are valid both in classical physics and in STR. In classical physics, they are called Galilean symmetries or transformations. In STR they are called Lorentz transformations. However, although the symmetries are very similar in both theories, the Lorentz transformations in STR involve features that are not evident in the classical theory. In fact, this difference only emerges for velocity boosts. Translations and rotations are identical in both theories. This is essentially because velocity boosts in STR involve transformations of the connection between proper time and ordinary space and time, which does not appear in classical theory.

The concept of valid coordinate transformations follows directly from that of valid object transformations. The point is that when we make an object transformation, we begin with a description of a process in a coordinate system, and end up with another description, of a different process, given in the same coordinate system. Now instead of transforming the processes involved, we can do the inverse, and make a transformation of the coordinate system, so that we end up with a new coordinate description of the original process, which looks exactly the same as the description of the transformed process in the original coordinate system.

This gives an alternative way of regarding the process, and its transformed image: instead of taking them as two different processes, we can take them as two different coordinate descriptions of the same process.

This is connected to the idea that certain aspects of the coordinate system are arbitrary or conventional. For instance, the choice of a particular origin for time or space is regarded as conventional: we can move the origins in our coordinate description, and we still have a valid system. This is only possible because the corresponding object transformations (time and space translations) are valid physical transformations.

Physicists tend to regard coordinate transformations and valid object transformations interchangeably and somewhat ambiguously, and the distinction between the two is often blurred in applied physics. While this doesn’t cause practical problems, it is important when learning the concepts of the theory to distinguish the two kinds of transformations clearly.

11. Velocity Boosts in STR and Classical Mechanics

STR and classical mechanics have exactly the same symmetries under translations of time and space, and rotations of space. They also both have symmetries under velocity boosts: both theories hold that, if we take a valid physical process, and give it a uniform additional velocity in some direction, we end with another valid physical process. But the transformation of space and time coordinates, and of proper time, are different for the two theories under a velocity boost. In classical physics, it is called a Galilean transformation, while for STR it is called a Lorentz transformation.

To see how the difference appears, we can take a stationary trajectory, and consider what happens when we apply a velocity boost in either theory.

coordinate systems 7

Figure 4. Classical and STR Velocity Boosts give different results.

In both diagrams, the green line is the original trajectory of a stationary particle, and it looks exactly the same in STR and classical mechanics. Proper time events (marked in blue) are equally spaced with the coordinate time intervals in both cases.

If we transform the classical trajectory by giving the particle a velocity (in this example, v = c/2) towards the right, the result (red line) is very simple: the proper time events remain equally spaced with coordinate time intervals. The same sequence of proper time events takes the same amount of coordinate time to complete. The classical particle moves a distance: Dx = v.Dt to the right, where Dt is the coordinate time duration of the original process.

But when we transform the STR particle, a strange thing happens: the proper time events become more widely spaced than the coordinate time intervals, and the same sequence of proper time events takes more coordinate time to complete. The STR particle moves a distance: Dx’ = v.Dt’ to the right, where: Dt’ > Dt, and hence: Dx’ > Dx.

The transformations of the coordinates of the (proper time) points of the original processes are shown in the following table.

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Table 1. Example of Velocity Transformation.

We can work out the general formula for the STR transformations of t’ and x’ in this example by using Equation (1). This requires finding a formula for the transformation of time-space coordinates:

(t, 0) ® (t’, x’)

We obtain this by applying Equation (1) in the (t’,x’) coordinate system, giving:

(1’)

It is crucial that this equation retains the same form under the Lorentz equation. In this special case, we have the additional facts that:

(i) Dt = Dt, and:(ii) Dx’ = vDt’

We substitute (i) and (ii) in (1’) to get:

This rearranges to give:

coordinate systems 11 and: coordinate systems 12

We can see that: Dx’/Dt’ = v. This is a special case of a Lorentz transformation for this simplest kind of trajectory. Note that if we think of this as a coordinate transformation which generates the appearance of this object transformation, we need to move the new coordinate system in the opposite direction to the motion of the object. I.e. if we define a new coordinate system, (x’,t’), moving at –v (i.e. to the left) with regard to the original (x,t) system, then the original trajectory (which appeared stationary in (x,t)) will appear to be moving with velocity +v (to the left) in (x’,t’). In general, object transformations correspond the inverse coordinate transformations.

12. Lorentz Transformations for Velocity Boost V in the x-direction

The previous transformations is only for points on the special line where: x = 0. More generally, we want to work out the formulae for transforming points anywhere in the coordinate system:

(t, x) ® (t’, x’)

The classical formulas are Galilean transformations, and they are very simple.

Galilean Velocity Boost:

(t, x) ® (t, x+vt)t’ = t

x’ = x+vt

The STR formulas are more general Lorentz transformations. The Galilean transformation is simple because time coordinates are unchanged, so that: t = t’. This means that simultaneity in time in classical physics is absolute: it does not depend upon the choice of coordinate system. We also have that distance between two points at a given moment of time is invariant, because if: x₂ -x₁ = Dx, then: x’₂ -x’₁ = (x₂+vt) – (x₁-vt) = Dx. Ordinary distance in space is the crucial invariant quantity in classical physics.

But in STR, we have a complex interdependence of time and space coordinates. This is seen because the transformation formulas for both t’ and x’ are functions of both x and t. I.e. there are functions f and g such that:

t’ = f(x,t) and: x’ = g(x,t)

These functions represent the Lorentz transformations. To give stationary objects a velocity V in the x-direction, these general functions are found to be Lorentz Transformation, and the factor coordinate systems 13 is called γ, letting us write these equations more simply as:

Lorentz Transformations: t’ = γ(t+Vx/c²) and: x’ = γ(x+Vt)

We can equally consider the corresponding coordinate transformation, which would generate the appearance of this object transformation in a new coordinate system. It is essentially the same as the object transformation – except it must go in the opposite direction. For the object transformation, which increases the velocity of stationary particles by the speed V in the x direction, corresponds to moving the coordinate system in the opposite direction. I.e. if we define a new coordinate system, and call it (x’,t’), and place this in motion with a speed –V (i.e. V in the negative-x-direction), relative to the (x,t) coordinate system, then the original stationary trajectories in (x,t)-coordinates will appear to have speed V in the new (x’,t’) coordinates.

Because the Lorentz transformation of processes leaves us with valid STR processes, the Lorentz transformation of a STR coordinate system leaves us with a valid coordinate system. In particular, the form of Equation (1) is preserved by the Lorentz transformation, so that we get: . This can be checked by substituting the formulas for t’ and x’ back into this equation, and simplifying; the resulting equation turns out to be identical to Equation (1).

13. Galilean Transformation of Coordinate System

One useful way to visualize the effect of a transformation is to make an ordinary space-time diagram, with the space and time axes drawn perpendicular to each other as usual, and then to draw the new set of coordinates on this diagram. In these diagrams, the space axes represent points which are measured to have the same time coordinates, and similarly, the time axes represent points which are measured to have the same space coordinates. When we make a velocity boost, these lines of simultaneity and same-position are altered.

This is shown first for a Galilean velocity boost, where in fact the lines of simultaneity remain the same, but the lines representing position are rotated:

coordinate systems 15

Figure 5. Galilean Velocity Boost.

In Figure 5, the (green) horizontal lines are lines of absolute simultaneity. They have the same coordinates in both t and t’.
The (blue) vertical lines are lines with the same x-coordinates.
The (gray) slanted lines are lines with the same x’-coordinates.
The spacing of the x’ coordinates is the same as the x coordinates, which means that relative distances between points are not affected.
The solid black arrow represents a stationary trajectory in (x,t).
An object transformation of +V moves it onto the green arrow, with velocity: v = c/2 in the (x,t)-system.
A coordinate transformation of +V, to a system (x’,t’) moving at +V with regard to (x,t), makes this green arrow appears stationary in the (x’,t’) system.
This coordinate transformation makes the black arrow appear to be moving at –V in (x’,t’) coordinates.

14. Lorentz Transformation of Coordinate System

In a Lorentz velocity boost, the time and space axes are both rotated, and the spacing is also changed.

coordinate systems 16

Figure 6. Rotation of Space and Time Coordinate Axes by a Lorentz Velocity Boost. Some proper time events are marked in blue.

To obtain the (x’,t’)-coordinates of a point defined in (x,t)-coordinates, we start at that point, and: (i) move parallel to the green lines, to find the intersection with the (red) t’-axis, which is marked with the x’-coordinates; and: (ii) move parallel to the red lines, to find the intersection with the (green) x’-axis, which is marked with the t’-coordinates. The effects of this transformation on a solid rod or ruler extending from x=0 to x=1, and stationary in (x,t), is shown in more detail below.

coordinate systems 17

Figure 7. Lorentz Velocity Boost. Magnified view of Figure 6 shows time and space dilation. The gray rectangle represents a unit of the space-time path of a rod (Rod 1) stationary in (x,t). The dark green lines represent a Lorentz (object) transformation of this trajectory, which is a second rod (Rod 2) moving at V in (x,t) coordinates. This is a unit of the space-time path of a stationary rod in (x’,t’).

15. Time and Space Dilation

Figure 7 shows how both time and space dilation effects work. To see this clearly, we need to consider the volumes of space-time that an object like a rod traces out.

The (gray) rectangle PQRS represents a space-time volume, for a stationary rod or ruler in the original frame. It is 1-meter long in original coordinates (Dx = 1), and is shown over 1 unit of proper time, which corresponds to one unit of coordinate time (Dt = 1).
The rectangle PQ’R’S’ (green edges) represents a second space-time volume, for a rod which appears to be moving in the original frame. This is how the space-time volume of the first rod transforms under a Lorentz transformation.
We may interpret the transformation as either: (i) a Lorentz velocity boost of the rod by velocity +V (object transformation), or equally: (ii) a Lorentz transformation to a new coordinate system, (x’,t’), moving at –V with regard to (x,t). Note that:
The length of the moving rod measured in x is now shorter than the stationary rod: Dx = 1/γ. This is space dilation.
The coordinate time between proper time events on the moving rod measured in t is now longer than for the stationary rod (Dt = γ). This is time dilation.

The need to fix the new coordinate system in this way can be worked out by considering the moving rod from the point of view of its own inertial system.

As viewed in its own inertial coordinate system, the green rectangle PQ’R’S’ appears as the space-time boundary for a stationary rod. In this frame:
PS’ appears stationary: it is a line where: x’ = 0.
PQ’ appears as a line of simultaneity, i.e. it is a line where: t’=0.
R’S’ is also a line of simultaneity in t’.
Points on R’S’ must have the time coordinate: t’=1, since it is at the time t’ when one unit of proper time has elapsed, and for the stationary object, Dt’ = Dt.
The length of PQ’ must be one unit in x’, since the moving rod appears the same length in its own inertial frame as the original stationary rod did.

Time and space dilation are often referred to as ‘perspective effects’ in discussions of STR. Objects and processes are said to ‘look’ shorter or longer when viewed in one inertial frame rather than in another. It is common to regard this effect as a purely ‘conventional’ feature, which merely reflects a conventional choice of reference frame. But this is rather misleading, because time and space dilation are very real physical effects, and they lead to completely different types of physical predictions than classical physics.

However, the symmetrical properties of the Lorentz transformation makes it impossible to use these features to tell whether one frame is ‘really moving’ and another is ‘really stationary’. For instance, if objects get shorter when they are placed in motion, then why do we not simply measure how long objects are, and use this to determine whether they are ‘really stationary’? The details in Figure 7 reveal why this does not work: the space dilation effect is reversed when we change reference frames. That is:

Measured in Frame 1, i.e. in (x,t)-coordinates, the stationary object (Rod 1) appears longer than the moving object (Rod 2). But:
Measured in Frame 2, using (x’,t’)-coordinates, the moving object (Rod 2) appears stationary, while the originally stationary object (Rod 1) moves. But now the space dilation effect appears reversed, and Rod 2 appears longer than Rod 1!

The reason this is not a real paradox or inconsistency can be seen from the point of view of Frame 2, because now Rod 1 at the moment of time t’ = 0 stretches from the point P to Q’’, rather than from P to Q, as in Frame 1. The line of simultaneity alters in the new frame, so that we measure the distance between a different pair of space-time events. And PQ’’ is now found to be shorter than PQ’, which is the length of Rod 2 in Frame 2.

There is no answer, within STR, as to which rod ‘really gets shorter’. Similarly there is no answer as to which rod ‘really has faster proper time’ – when we switch to Frame 2, we find that Rod 2 has a faster rate of proper time with regard to coordinate time, reversing the time dilation effect apparent in Frame 1. In this sense, we could consider these effects a matter of ‘perspective’ – although it is more accurate to say that in STR, in its usual interpretation, there are simply no facts about absolute length, or absolute time, or absolute simultaneity, at all.

However, this does not mean that time and space dilation are not real effects. They are displayed in other situations where there is no ambiguity. One example is the twins’ paradox, where proper time slows down in an absolute way for a moving twin. And there are equally real physical effects resulting from space dilation. It is just that these effects cannot be used to determine an absolute frame of rest.

16. The Full Special Theory of Relativity

So far, we have only examined the most basic part of STR: the valid STR transformations for space, time, and proper time, and the way these three quantities are connected together. This is the most fundamental part of the theory. It represents relativistic kinematics. It already has very powerful implications. But the fully developed theory is far more extensive: it results from Einstein’s idea that the Lorentz transformations represent a universal invariance, applicable to all physics. Einstein formulated this in 1905: “The laws of physics are invariant under Lorentz transformations (when going from one inertial system to another arbitrarily chosen inertial system)”. Adopting this general principle, he explored the ramifications for the concepts of mass, energy, momentum, and force.

The most famous result is Einstein’s equation for energy: E = mc². This involves the extension of the Lorentz transformation to mass. Einstein found that when we Lorentz transform a stationary particle with original rest-mass m₀, to set it in motion with a velocity V, we cannot regard it as maintaining the same total mass. Instead, its mass becomes larger: m = γm₀, with γ defined as above. This is another deep contradiction with classical physics.

Einstein showed that this requires us to reformulate our concept of energy. In classical physics, kinetic energy is given by: E = ½ mv². In STR, there is a more general definition of energy, as: E = mc². A stationary particle then has a basic ‘rest mass energy’ of m₀c². When it is set in motion, its energy is increased purely by the increase in mass, and this is kinetic energy. So we find in STR that:

Kinetic Energy = mc²-m₀c² = (γ-1)m₀c²

For low velocities, with: v << c, it is easily shown that: (γ-1)c² is very close to ½v², so this corresponds to the classical result in the classical limit of low energies. But for high energies, the behavior of particles is very different. The discovery that there is an underlying energy of m0c² simply from rest-mass is what made nuclear reactors and nuclear bombs possible: they convert tiny amounts of rest mass into vast amounts of thermal energy.

The main application Einstein explored first was the theory of electromagnetism, and his most famous paper, in which he defined STR in 1905, is called “Electrodynamics of Moving Bodies”. In fact, Lorentz, Poincaré and others already knew that they needed to apply the Lorentz transformation to Maxwell’s theory of classical electromagnetism, and had succeeded a few years earlier in formulating a theory which is extremely similar to Einstein’s in its predictions. Some important experimental verification of this was also available before Einstein’s work (most famously, the Michelson-Morley experiment). But his theory went much further. He radically reformulated the concepts that we use to analyse force, energy, momentum, and so forth. In this sense, his new theory was primarily a philosophical and conceptual achievement, rather than a new experimental discovery of the kind traditionally regarded as the epitome of empirical science.

He also attributed his universal ‘principle of relativity’ to the very nature of space and time itself. With important contributions by Minkowski, this gave rise to the modern view that physics is based on an inseparable combination of space and time, called space-time. Minkowski treated this as a kind of ‘geometric’ entity, based on regarding our Equation (1) as a ‘metric equation’ describing the geometric nature of space-time. This view is called the ‘geometric explanation’ of relativity theory, and this approach led Einstein even deeper into modern physics, when he applied this new conception to the theory of gravity, and discovered a generalised theory of space-time.

The nature of this ‘geometric explanation’ of the connection between space, time, and proper time is one of the most fascinating topics in the philosophy of physics. But it involves the General Theory of Relativity, which goes beyond STR.

17. References and Further Reading

The literature on relativity and its philosophical implications is enormous – and still growing rapidly. The following short selection illustrates some of the range of material available. Original publication dates are in brackets.

Bondi, Hermann. 1962. Relativity and Common Sense. Heinemann Educational Books.
- A clear exposition of basic relativity theory for beginners, with a minimum of equations. Contains useful discussions of the Twins Paradox and other topics.
Einstein, Albert. 1956 (1921). The Meaning of Relativity. (The Stafford Little Lectures of Princeton University.) Princeton University Press.
- Einstein’s account of the principles of his famous theory. Simple in parts, but mainly a fairly technical summary, requiring a good knowledge of physics.
Epstein, Lewis Carroll. 1983. Relativity Visualized. Insight Press. San Francisco.
- A clear, simple, and rather unique introduction to relativity theory for beginners. Epstein illustrates the functional relationships between space, time, and proper time in a clear and direct way, using novel geometric presentations.
Grunbaum, Adolf. 1963. Philosophical Problems of Space and Time. Knopf, New York.
- A collection of original studies by one of the seminal philosophers of relativity theory, this covers an impressive range of issues, and remains an important starting place for many recent philosophical studies.
Lorentz, H. A., A. Einstein, H. Minkowski and H. Weyl. 1923. The Principle of Relativity. A Collection of Original Memoirs on the Special and General Theory of Relativity. Trans. W. Perrett and G.B. Jeffery. Methuen. London.
- These are the major figures in the early development of relativity theory, apart from Poincare, who simultaneously with Lorentz formulated the ‘pre-relativistic’ version of electromagnetic theory, which contains most of the mathematical basis of STR, shortly before Einstein’s paper of 1905. While Einstein deeply admired Lorentz – despite their permanent disagreements about STR – he paid no attention to Poincare.
Newton, Isaac. 1686. Mathematical Principles of Natural Philosophy.
- Every serious student should read Newton’s “Definitions” and “Scholium”, where he introduces his concepts of time and space.
Planck, Max. 1998 (1909). Eight Lectures on Theoretical Physics.
- Planck elegantly summarizes the revolutionary discoveries that characterized the first decade of 20th Century physics. Lecture 8 is one of the earliest accounts of relativity theory. This classic work shows Planck’s penetrating vision of many fundamental themes that soon came to dominate physics.
Reichenbach, Hans. 1958 (1928). The Philosophy of Space and Time. Dover, New York.
- An influential early study of the concepts of space and time, and the relativistic revolution. Although Reichenbach’s approach is underpinned by his positivistic program, which is rejected today by philosophers, the central issues are of continuing interest.
Russell, Bertrand. 1977 (1925). ABC of Relativity. Unwin Paperbacks, London.
- A early popular exposition of the meaning of relativity theory by one of the most influential 20th century philosophers, this presents key philosophical issues with Russell’s characteristic simplicity.
Schlipp, P.A. (Ed.) 1949. Albert Einstein: Philosopher-Scientist. The Library of Living Philosophers.
- A classic collection of papers on Einstein and relativity theory.
Spivak, M. 1979. A Comprehensive Introduction to Differential Geometry. Publish or Perish. Berkeley.
- An advanced mathematical introduction to the modern approach to differentiable manifolds, which developed in the 1960’s. Philosophical interest lies in the detailed semantics for coordinate systems, and the generalizations of concepts of geometry, such as the tangent vector.
Tipler, Paul A. 1982. Physics. Worth Publishers Ltd.
- An extended introductory textbook for undergraduates, Chapter 35, “Relativity Theory”, is a typical modern introduction to relativity theory.
Torretti, Roberto. 1983/1996. Relativity and Geometry. Dover, New York.
- An excellent source for the specialist philosopher, summarizing history and concepts of both the Special and General Theories, with extended bibliography. Combines excellent technical summaries with detailed historical surveys.
Wangsness, Roald K. 1979. Electromagnetic Fields. John Wiley & Sons Ltd.
- This is a typical advanced modern undergraduate textbook on electromagnetism. The final chapter explains how the structure of electrodynamics is derived from the principles of STR.

Back to the main “Time” article.

Author Information

Andrew Holster
Email: ATASA@clear.net.nz
New Zealand

Diels-Kranz Numbering System

Of the writings of the Presocratics, only quotations embedded in the works of later authors have survived. These quotations, along with reports about the Presocratics and imitations of their works, were first compiled into a standard edition (Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker) in the nineteenth century by Hermann Diels (1848-1922) with revisions by Walther Kranz and subsequent editors, in a complete edition of all the works of Presocratic authors which has become standard in the field of ancient philosophy. The works of Presocratics, therefore, are normally referred to by DK numbers. In Diels-Kranz, each author is assigned a number, and within that author’s number, entries are divided into three groups labeled alphabetically:

testimonia: ancient accounts of the authors’ life and doctrines
ipsissima verba (literally, exact words, sometimes also termed “fragments”): the exact words of the author
imitations: works which take the author as a model

Within each of these three groups, individual fragments or testimonia are assigned sequential numbers. So, for example, since Protagoras is the eightieth author in Diels-Kranz, the third testimony concerning him, a generally unreliable short biography by Hesychius, would be referred to as DK80a3.

Diels, Hermann and Walther Kranz. Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Zurich: Weidmann, 1985.

Freeman, Kathleen. Ancilla to the Pre-Socratic Philosophers. Cambridge: Harvard Univ Pr., 1983 (reprint edition).

This book is a complete English translation of the ‘b’ passages–the so-called ‘fragments’–from Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker.

Author Information

Carol Poster
Email: cposter@english.fsu.edu
Florida State University

Rudolf Carnap (1891—1970)

carnap02 Rudolf Carnap, a German-born philosopher and naturalized U.S. citizen, was a leading exponent of logical positivism and was one of the major philosophers of the twentieth century. He made significant contributions to philosophy of science, philosophy of language, the theory of probability, inductive logic and modal logic. He rejected metaphysics as meaningless because metaphysical statements cannot be proved or disproved by experience. He asserted that many philosophical problems are indeed pseudo-problems, the outcome of a misuse of language. Some of them can be resolved when we recognize that they are not expressing matters of fact, but rather concern the choice between different linguistic frameworks. Thus the logical analysis of language becomes the principal instrument in resolving philosophical problems. Since ordinary language is ambiguous, Carnap asserted the necessity of studying philosophical issues in artificial languages, which are governed by the rules of logic and mathematics. In such languages, he dealt with the problems of the meaning of a statement, the different interpretations of probability, the nature of explanation, and the distinctions between analytic and synthetic, a priori and a posteriori, and necessary and contingent statements.

Life
The Structure of Scientific Theories
Analytic and Synthetic
Meaning and Verifiability
Probability and Inductive Logic
Modal Logic and the Philosophy of Language
Philosophy of Physics
Carnap’s Heritage
References and Further Reading
1. Carnap’s Works
2. Other Sources

1. Life

Rudolf Carnap was born on May 18, 1891, in Ronsdorf, Germany. In 1898, after his father’s death, his family moved to Barmen, where Carnap studied at the Gymnasium. From 1910 to1914 he studied philosophy, physics and mathematics at the universities of Jena and Freiburg. He studied Kant under Bruno Bauch and later recalled how a whole year was devoted to the discussion of The Critique of Pure Reason. Carnap became especially interested in Kant’s theory of space. Carnap took three courses from Gottlob Frege in 1910, 1913 and 1914. Frege was professor of mathematics at Jena. During those courses, Frege expounded his system of logic and its applications in mathematics. However, Carnap’s principal interest at that time was in physics, and by 1913 he was planning to write his dissertation on thermionic emission. His studies were interrupted by World War I and Carnap served at the front until 1917. He then moved to Berlin and studied the theory of relativity. At that time, Albert Einstein was professor of physics at the University of Berlin.

After the war, Carnap developed a new dissertation, this time on an axiomatic system for the physical theory of space and time. He submitted a draft to physicist Max Wien, director of the Institute of Physics at the University of Jena, and to Bruno Bauch. Both found the work interesting, but Wien told Carnap the dissertation was pertinent to philosophy, not to physics, while Bauch said it was relevant to physics. Carnap then chose to write a dissertation under the direction of Bauch on the theory of space from a philosophical point of view. Entitled Der Raum (Space), the work was clearly influenced by Kantian philosophy. Submitted in 1921, it was published the following year in a supplemental issue of Kant-Studien.

Carnap’s involvement with the Vienna Circle developed over the next few years. He met Hans Reichenbach at a conference on philosophy held at Erlangen in 1923. Reichenbach introduced him to Moritz Schlick, then professor of the theory of inductive science at Vienna. Carnap visited Schlick—and the Vienna Circle—in 1925 and the following year moved to Vienna to become assistant professor at the University of Vienna. He became a leading member of the Vienna Circle and, in 1929, with Hans Hahn and Otto Neurath, he wrote the manifesto of the Circle.

In 1928, Carnap published The Logical Structure of the World, in which he developed a formal version of empiricism arguing that all scientific terms are definable by means of a phenomenalistic language. The great merit of the book was the rigor with which Carnap developed his theory. In the same year he published Pseudoproblems in Philosophy asserting the meaninglessness of many philosophical problems. He was closely involved in the First Conference on Epistemology, held in Prague in 1929 and organized by the Vienna Circle and the Berlin Circle (the latter founded by Reichenbach in 1928). The following year, he and Reichenbach founded the journal Erkenntnis. At the same time, Carnap met Alfred Tarski, who was developing his semantical theory of truth. Carnap was also interested in mathematical logic and wrote a manual of logic, entitled Abriss der Logistik (1929).

In 1931, Carnap moved to Prague to become professor of natural philosophy at the German University. It was there that he made his important contribution to logic with The Logical Syntax of Language (1934). His stay in Prague, however, was cut short by the Nazi rise to power. In 1935, with the aid of the American philosophers Charles Morris and Willard Van Orman Quine, whom he had met in Prague the previous year, Carnap moved to the United States. He became an American citizen in 1941.

From 1936 to 1952, Carnap was a professor at the University of Chicago (with the year 1940-41 spent as a visiting professor at Harvard University). He then spent two years at the Institute for Advanced Study at Princeton before taking an appointment at the University of California at Los Angeles.

In the 1940s, stimulated by Tarskian model theory, Carnap became interested in semantics. He wrote several books on semantics: Introduction to Semantics (1942), Formalization of Logic (1943), and Meaning and Necessity: A Study in Semantics and Modal Logic (1947). In Meaning and Necessity, Carnap used semantics to explain modalities. Subsequently he began to work on the structure of scientific theories. His main concerns were (i) to give an account of the distinction between analytic and synthetic statements and (ii) to give a suitable formulation of the verifiability principle; that is, to find a criterion of significance appropriate to scientific language. Other important works were “Meaning Postulates” (1952) and “Observation Language and Theoretical Language” (1958). The latter sets out Carnap’s definitive view on the analytic-synthetic distinction. “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” (1958) is an attempt to give a tentative definition of a criterion of significance for scientific language. Carnap was also interested in formal logic (Introduction to Symbolic Logic, 1954) and in inductive logic (Logical Foundations of Probability, 1950; The Continuum of Inductive Methods, 1952). The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap, ed. by Paul Arthur Schilpp, was published in 1963 and includes an intellectual autobiography. Philosophical Foundations of Physics, ed. by Martin Gardner, was published in 1966. Carnap was working on the theory of inductive logic when he died on September 14, 1970, at Santa Monica, California.

2. The Structure of Scientific Theories

In Carnap’s opinion, a scientific theory is an interpreted axiomatic formal system. It consists of:

a formal language, including logical and non-logical terms;
a set of logical-mathematical axioms and rules of inference;
a set of non-logical axioms, expressing the empirical portion of the theory;
a set of meaning postulates stating the meaning of non-logical terms, which formalize the analytic truths of the theory;
a set of rules of correspondence, which give an empirical interpretation of the theory.

The sets of meaning postulates and rules of correspondence may be included in the set of non-logical axioms. Indeed, meaning postulates and rules of correspondence are not usually explicitly distinguished from non-logical axioms; only one set of axioms is formulated. One of the main purposes of the philosophy of science is to show the difference between the various kinds of statements.

The Language of Scientific Theories The language of a scientific theory consists of:

a set of symbols and
rules to ensure that a sequence of symbols is a well-formed formula, that is, correct with respect to syntax.

Among the symbols of the language are logical and non-logical terms. The set of logical terms include logical symbols, e.g., connectives and quantifiers, and mathematical symbols, e.g., numbers, derivatives, and integrals. Non-logical terms are divided into observational and theoretical. They are symbols denoting physical entities, properties or relations such as ‘blue’, ‘cold’, ‘ warmer than’, ‘proton’, ‘electromagnetic field’. Formulas are divided into: (i) logical statements, which do not contain non-logical terms; (ii) observational statements, which contain observational terms but no theoretical terms; (iii) purely theoretical statements, which contain theoretical terms but no observational terms and (iv) rules of correspondence, which contain both observational and theoretical terms.

Classification of statements in a scientific language

type of statement

observational terms

theoretical terms

logical statements No No

observational statements Yes No

purely theoretical statements No Yes

rules of correspondence Yes Yes

Observational language contains only logical and observational statements; theoretical language contains logical and theoretical statements and rules of correspondence.

The distinction between observational and theoretical terms is a central tenet of logical positivism and at the core of Carnap’s view on scientific theories. In his book Philosophical Foundations of Physics (1966), Carnap bases the distinction between observational and theoretical terms on the distinction between two kinds of scientific laws, namely empirical laws and theoretical laws.

An empirical law deals with objects or properties that can be observed or measured by means of simple procedures. This kind of law can be directly confirmed by empirical observations. It can explain and forecast facts and be thought of as an inductive generalization of such factual observations. Typically, an empirical law which deals with measurable physical quantities, can be established by means of measuring such quantities in suitable cases and then interpolating a simple curve between the measured values. For example, a physicist could measure the volume V, the temperature T and the pressure P of a gas in diverse experiments, and he could find the law PV=RT, for a suitable constant R.

A theoretical law, on the other hand, is concerned with objects or properties we cannot observe or measure but only infer from direct observations. A theoretical law cannot be justified by means of direct observation. It is not an inductive generalization but a hypothesis reaching beyond experience. While an empirical law can explain and forecast facts, a theoretical law can explain and forecast empirical laws. The method of justifying a theoretical law is indirect: a scientist does not test the law itself but, rather, the empirical laws that are among its consequences.

The distinction between empirical and theoretical laws entails the distinction between observational and theoretical properties, and hence between observational and theoretical terms. The distinction in many situations is clear, for example: the laws that deal with the pressure, volume and temperature of a gas are empirical laws and the corresponding terms are observational; while the laws of quantum mechanics are theoretical. Carnap admits, however, that the distinction is not always clear and the line of demarcation often arbitrary. In some ways the distinction between observational and theoretical terms is similar to that between macro-events, which are characterized by physical quantities that remain constant over a large portion of space and time, and micro-events, where physical quantities change rapidly in space or time.

3. Analytic and Synthetic

To the logical empiricist, all statements can be divided into two classes: analytic a priori and synthetic a posteriori. There can be no synthetic a priori statements. A substantial aspect of Carnap’s work was his attempt to give precise definition to the distinction between analytic and synthetic statements.

In The Logical Syntax of Language (1934), Carnap studied a formal language that could express classical mathematics and scientific theories, for example, classical physics. Carnap would have known Kurt Gödel’s 1931 article on the incompleteness of mathematics. He was, therefore, aware of the substantial difference between the two concepts of proof and consequence: some statements, despite being a logical consequence of the axioms of mathematics, are not provable by means of these axioms. He would not, however, have been able to take account of Alfred Tarski’s essay on semantics, first published in Polish in 1933. Tarski’s essay led to the notion of logical consequence being regarded as a semantic concept and defined by means of model theory. These circumstances explain how Carnap, in The Logical Syntax of Language, gave a purely syntactic formulation of the concept of logical consequence. However, he did define a new rule of inference, now called the omega-rule, but formerly called the Carnap rule:

From the infinite series of premises A(1), A(2), … , A(n), A(n+1) ,…, we can infer the conclusion (x)A(x)

Carnap defines the notion of logical consequence in the following way: a statement A is a logical consequence of a set S of statements if and only if there is a proof of A based on the set S; it is admissible to use the omega-rule in the proof of A. In the definition of the notion of provable, however, a statement A is provable by means of a set S of statements if and only if there is a proof of A based on the set S, but the omega-rule is not admissible in the proof of A. (A formal system which admits the use of the omega-rule is complete, so Gödel’s incompleteness theorem does not apply to such formal systems.

Carnap then proceeded to define some kinds of statements: (i) a statement is L-true if and only if it is a logical consequence of the empty set of statements; (ii) a statement is L-false if and only if all statements are a logical consequence of it; (iii) a statement is analytic if and only if it is L-true or L-false; (iv) a statement is synthetic if and only if is not analytic. Carnap thus defines analytic statements as logically determined statements: their truth depends on logical rules of inference and is independent of experience. Thus, analytic statements are a priori while synthetic statements are a posteriori, because they are not logically determined.

Carnap maintained his definitions of statements in his article “Testability and Meaning” (1936) and his book Meaning and Necessity (1947). In “Testability and Meaning,” he introduced semantic concepts: a statement is analytic if and only if it is logically true; it is self-contradictory if and only if it is logically false. In any other case, the statement is synthetic. In Meaning and Necessity. Carnap first defines the notion of L-true (a statement is L-true if its truth depends on semantic rules) and then defines the notion of L-false (a statements if L-false if its negation is L-true). A statement is L-determined if it is L-true or L-false; analytic statements are L-determined, while synthetic statements are not L-determined. This is very similar to the definitions Carnap gave in The Logical Syntax of Language but with the change from syntactic to semantic concepts.

In 1951, Quine published the article “Two Dogmas of Empiricism,” in which he disputed the distinction made between analytic and synthetic statements. In response, Carnap partially changed his point of view on this problem. His first response to Quine came in “Meaning postulates” (1952) where Carnap suggested that analytic statements are those which can be derived from a set of appropriate sentences that he called meaning postulates. Such sentences define the meaning of non logical terms and thus the set of analytic statements is not equal to the set of logically true statements. Later, in “Observation language and theoretical language” (1958), he expressed a general method for determining a set of meaning postulates for the language of a scientific theory. He further expounded on this method in his reply to Carl Gustav Hempel in The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap (1963), and in Philosophical Foundations of Physics (1966). Suppose the number of non-logical axioms is finite. Let T be the conjunction of all purely theoretical axioms, and C the conjunction of all correspondence postulates and TC the conjunction of T and C. The theory is equivalent to the single axiom TC. Carnap formulates the following problems: how can we find two statements, say A and R, so that A expresses the analytic portion of the theory (that is, all consequences of A are analytic) while R expresses the empirical portion (that is, all consequences of R are synthetic)? The empirical content of the theory is formulated by means of a Ramsey sentence (a discovery of the English philosopher Frank Ramsey). Carnap’s solution to the problem builds a Ramsey sentence on the following instructions:

Replace every theoretical term in TC with a variable.
Add an appropriate number of existential quantifiers at the beginning of the sentence.

Look at the following example. Let TC(O 1 ,..,O n ,T 1 ,…,T m ) be the conjunction of T and C; in TC there are observational terms O 1 …O n and theoretical terms T 1 …T m . The Ramsey sentence (R) is

EX 1 …EX m TC(O 1 ,…,O n ,X 1 ,…,X m )

Every observational statement which is derivable from TC is also derivable from R and vice versa so that, R expresses exactly the empirical portion of the theory. Carnap proposes the statement R TC as the only meaning postulate; this became known as the Carnap sentence. Note that every empirical statement that can be derived from the Carnap sentence is logically true, and thus the Carnap sentence lacks empirical consequences. So, a statement is analytic if it is derivable from the Carnap sentence; otherwise the statement is synthetic. The requirements of Carnap’s method can be summarized as follows : (i) non-logical axioms must be explicitly stated, (ii) the number of non-logical axioms must be finite and (iii) observational terms must be clearly distinguished from theoretical terms.

4. Meaning and Verifiability

Perhaps the most famous tenet of logical empiricism is the verifiability principle, according to which a synthetic statement is meaningful only if it is verifiable. Carnap sought to give a logical formulation of this principle. In The Logical Structure of the World (1928) he asserted that a statement is meaningful only if every non-logical term is explicitly definable by means of a very restricted phenomenalistic language. A few years later, Carnap realized that this thesis was untenable because a phenomenalistic language is insufficient to define physical concepts. Thus he choose an objective language (“thing language”) as the basic language, one in which every primitive term is a physical term. All other terms (biological, psychological, cultural) must be defined by means of basic terms. To overcome the problem that an explicit definition is often impossible, Carnap used dispositional concepts, which can be introduced by means of reduction sentences. For example, if A, B, C and D are observational terms and Q is a dispositional concept, then

(x)[Ax → (Bx ↔ Qx)]
(x)[Cx → (Dx ↔ ~Qx)]

are reduction sentences for Q. In “Testability and Meaning” (1936) Carnap revised the new verifiability principle in this way: all terms must be reducible, by means of definitions or reduction sentences, to the observational language. But this proved to be inadequate. K. R. Popper showed not only that some metaphysical terms can be reduced to the observational language and thus fulfill Carnap’s requirements, but also that some genuine physical concepts are forbidden. Carnap acknowledged that criticism and in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” (1956) sought to develop a further definition. The main philosophical properties of Carnap’s new principle can be outlined under three headings. First, of all, the significance of a term becomes a relative concept: a term is meaningful with respect to a given theory and a given language. The meaning of a concept thus depends on the theory in which that concept is used. This represents a significant modification in empiricism’s theory of meaning. Secondly, Carnap explicitly acknowledges that some theoretical terms cannot be reduced to the observational language: they acquire an empirical meaning by means of the links with other reducible theoretical terms. Third, Carnap realizes that the principle of operationalism is too restrictive. Operationalism was formulated by the American physicist Percy Williams Bridgman (1882-1961) in his book The Logic of Modern Physics (1927). According to Bridgman, every physical concept is defined by the operations a physicist uses to apply it. Bridgman asserted that the curvature of space-time, a concept used by Einstein in his general theory of relativity, is meaningless, because it is not definable by means of operations., Bridgman subsequently changed his philosophical point of view, and admitted there is an indirect connection with observations. Perhaps influenced by Popper’s criticism, or by the problematic consequences of a strict operationalism, Carnap changed his earlier point of view and freely admitted a very indirect connection between theoretical terms and the observational language.

5. Probability and Inductive Logic

A variety of interpretations of probability have been proposed:

Classical interpretation. The probability of an event is the ratio of the favorable outcomes to the possible outcomes. For example: a die is thrown with the result that “the score is five”. There are six possible outcomes with only one favorable; thus the probability of “the score is five” is one sixth.
Axiomatic interpretation. The probability is whatever fulfils the axioms of the theory of probability. In the early 1930s, the Russian mathematician Andrei Nikolaevich Kolmogorov (1903-1987) formulated the first axiomatic system for probability.
Frequency interpretation, now the favored interpretation in empirical science. The probability of an event in a sequence of events is the limit of the relative frequency of that event. Example: throw a die several times and record the scores; the relative frequency of “the score is five” is about one sixth; the limit of the relative frequency is exactly one sixth.
Probability as a degree of confirmation. This was an approach supported by Carnap and students of inductive logic. The probability of a statement is the degree of confirmation the empirical evidence gives to the statement. Example: the statement “the score is five” receives a partial confirmation by the evidence; its degree of confirmation is one sixth.
Subjective interpretation. The probability is a measure of the degree of belief. A special case is the theory that the probability is a fair betting quotient – this interpretation was supported by Carnap. Example: suppose you bet that the score would be five; you bet a dollar and, if you win, you will receive six dollars: this is a fair bet.
Propensity interpretation. This is a proposal of K. R. Popper. The probability of an event is an objective property of the event. For example: the physical properties of a die (the die is homogeneous; it has six sides; on every side there is a different number between one and six; etc.) explain the fact that the limit of the relative frequency of “the score is five” is one sixth.

Carnap devoted himself to giving an account of the probability as a degree of confirmation. The philosophically most significant consequences of his research arise from his assertion that the probability of a statement, with respect to a given body of evidence, is a logical relation between the statement and the evidence. Thus it is necessary to build an inductive logic; that is, a logic which studies the logical relations between statements and evidence. Inductive logic would give us a mathematical method of evaluating the reliability of an hypothesis. In this way inductive logic would answer the problem raised by David Hume’s analysis of induction. Of course, we cannot be sure that an hypothesis is true; but we can evaluate its degree of confirmation and we can thus compare alternative theories.

In spite of the abundance of logical and mathematical methods Carnap used in his own research on the inductive logic, he was not able to formulate a theory of the inductive confirmation of scientific laws. In fact, in Carnap’s inductive logic, the degree of confirmation of every universal law is always zero.

Carnap tried to employ the physical-mathematical theory of thermodynamic entropy to develop a comprehensive theory of inductive logic, but his plan never progressed beyond an outline stage. His works on entropy were published posthumously.

6. Modal Logic and the Philosophy of Language

The following table, which is an adaptation of a similar table Carnap used in Meaning and Necessity, shows the relations between modal properties such as necessary and impossible and logical properties such as L-true, L-false, analytic, synthetic. The symbol N means “necessarily”, so that Np means “necessarily p” or “p is necessary.”

Modal and logical properties of statements

Modalities

Formalization

Logical status

p is necessary Np L true, analytic

p is impossible N~p L false, contradictory

p is contingent ~Np & ~N~p factual, synthetic

p is not necessary ~Np Not L true

p is possible ~N~p Not L false

p is not contingent Np v N~p L determined, not synthetic

Carnap identifies the necessity of a statement p with its logical truth: a statement is necessary if and only if it is logically true. Thus modal properties can be defined by means of the usual logical properties of statements. Np, i.e., “necessarily p”, is true if and only if p is logically true. He defines the possibility of p as “it is not necessary that not p”. That is, “possibly p” is defined as ~N~p. The impossibility of p means that p is logically false. It must be stressed that, in Carnap’s opinion, every modal concept is definable by means of the logical properties of statements. Modal concepts are thus explicable from a classical point of view (meaning “using classical logic”, e.g., first order logic). Carnap was aware that the symbol N is definable only in the meta-language, not in the object language. Np means “p is logically true”, and the last statement belongs to the meta-language; thus N is not explicitly definable in the language of a formal logic, and we cannot eliminate the term N. More precisely, we can define N only by means of another modal symbol we take as a primitive symbol, so that at least one modal symbol is required among the primitive symbols.

Carnap’s formulation of modal logic is very important from a historical point of view. Carnap gave the first semantic analysis of a modal logic, using Tarskian model theory to explain the conditions in which “necessarily p” is true. He also solved the problem of the meaning of the statement (x)N[Ax], where Ax is a sentence in which the individual variable x occurs. Carnap showed that (x)N[Ax] is equivalent to N[(x)Ax] or, more precisely, he proved we can assume its equivalence without contradictions.

From a broader philosophical point of view, Carnap believed that modalities did not require a new conceptual framework; a semantic logic of language can explain the modal concepts. The method he used in explaining modalities was a typical example of his philosophical analysis. Another interesting example is the explanation of belief-sentences which Carnap gave in Meaning and Necessity. Carnap asserts that two sentences have the same extension if they are equivalent, i.e., if they are both true or both false. On the other hand, two sentences have the same intension if they are logically equivalent, i.e., their equivalence is due to the semantic rules of the language. Let A be a sentence in which another sentence occurs, say p. A is called “extensional with respect to p” if and only if the truth value of A does not change if we substitute the sentence p with an equivalent sentence q. A is called “intensional with respect to p” if and only if (i) A is not extensional with respect to p and (ii) the truth of A does not change if we substitute the sentence p with a logically equivalent sentence q. The following examples arise from Carnap’s assertions:

The sentence A v B is extensional with respect to both A and B; we can substitute A and B with equivalent sentences and the truth value of A v B does not change.
Suppose A is true but not L-true; therefore the sentences A v ~A and A are equivalent (both are true) and, of course, they are not L-equivalent. The sentence N(A v ~A) is true and the sentence N(A) is false; thus N(A) is not extensional with respect to A. On the contrary, if C is a sentence L-equivalent to A v ~A, then N(A v ~A) and N(C) are both true: N(A) is intensional with respect to A.

There are sentences which are neither extensional not intensional; for example, belief-sentences. Carnap’s example is “John believes that D”. Suppose that “John believes that D” is true; let A be a sentence equivalent to D and let B be a sentence L-equivalent to D. It is possible that the sentences “John believes that A” and “John believes that B” are false. In fact, John can believe that a sentence is true, but he can believe that a logically equivalent sentence is false. To explain belief-sentences, Carnap defines the notion of intensional isomorphism. In broad terms, two sentences are intensionally isomorphic if and only if their corresponding elements are L-equivalent. In the belief-sentence “John believes that D” we can substitute D with an intensionally isomorphic sentence C.

7. Philosophy of Physics

The first and the last books Carnap published during his lifetime were concerned with the philosophy of physics: his doctoral dissertation (Der Raum, 1922) and Philosophical Foundations of Physics, ed. by Martin Gardner, 1966. Der Raum deals with the philosophy of space. Carnap recognizes the difference between three kinds of theories of space: formal, physical and intuitive s. Formal space is analytic a priori; it is concerned with the formal properties of the space that is with those properties which are a logical consequence of a definite set of axioms. Physical space is synthetic a posteriori; it is the object of natural science, and we can know its structure only by means of experience. Intuitive space is synthetic a priori, and is known via a priori intuition. According to Carnap, the distinction between three different kinds of space is similar to the distinction between three different aspects of geometry: projective, metric and topological respectively.

Some aspects of Der Raum remain very interesting. First, Carnap accepts a neo-Kantian philosophical point of view. Intuitive space, with its synthetic a priori character, is a concession to Kantian philosophy. Second, Carnap uses the methods of mathematical logic; for example, the characterization of intuitive space is given by means of Hilbert’s axioms for topology. Thirdly, the distinction between formal and physical space is similar to the distinction between mathematical and physical geometry. This distinction, first proposed by Hans Reichenbach and later accepted by Carnap, and became the official position of logical empiricism on the philosophy of space.

Carnap also developed a formal system for space-time topology. He asserted (1925) that space relations are based on the causal propagation of a signal, while the causal propagation itself is based on the time order.

Philosophical Foundations of Physics is a clear and approachable survey of topics from the philosophy of physics based on Carnap’s university lectures. Some theories expressed there are not those of Carnap alone, but they belong to the common heritage of logical empiricism. The subjects dealt with in the book include:

The structure of scientific explanation: deductive and probabilistic explanation.
The philosophical and physical significance of non-Euclidean geometry; the theory of space in the general theory of relativity. Carnap argues against Kantian philosophy, especially against the synthetic a priori, and against conventionalism. He gives a clear explanation of the main properties of non-Euclidean geometry.
Determinism and quantum physics.
The nature of scientific language. Carnap deals with (i) the distinction between observational and theoretical terms, (ii) the distinction between analytic and synthetic statements and (iii) quantitative concepts.

As a sample of the content of Philosophical Foundations of Physics we can briefly look at Carnap’s thought on scientific explanation. Carnap accepts the classical theory developed by Carl Gustav Hempel. Carnap gives the following example to explain the general structure of a scientific explanation:

(x)(Px→ Qx)
Pa
———
Qa

where the first statement is a scientific law; the second, is a description of the initial conditions; and the third, is the description of the event we want to explain. The last statement is a logical consequence of the first and the second, which are the premises of the explanation. A scientific explanation is thus a logical derivation of an appropriate statement from a set of premises, which state universal laws and initial conditions. According to Carnap, there is another kind of scientific explanation, probabilistic explanation, in which at least one universal law is not a deterministic law, but a probabilistic law. Again Carnap’s example is:

fr(Q,P) = 0.8
Pa
———-
Qa

where the first sentence means “the relative frequency of Q with respect to P is 0.8”. Qa is not a logical consequence of the premises; therefore this kind of explanation determines only a certain degree of confirmation for the event we want to explain.

8. Carnap’s Heritage

Carnap’s work has stimulated much debate. A substantial scholarly literature, both critical and supportive, has developed from examination of his thought. With respect to the analytic-synthetic distinction, Ryszard Wojcicki and Marian Przelecki – two Polish logicians – formulated a semantic definition of the distinction between analytic and synthetic. They proved that the Carnap sentence is the weakest meaning postulate, i.e., every meaning postulate entails the Carnap sentence. As a result, the set of analytic statements which are a logical consequence of the Carnap sentence is the smallest set of analytic statements. Wojcicki and Przelecki’s research is independent of the distinction between observational and theoretical terms, i.e., their suggested definition also works in a purely theoretical language. They also dispense with the requirement for a finite number of non-logical axioms.

The tentative definition of meaningfulness that Carnap proposed in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” has been proved untenable. See, for example, David Kaplan, “Significance and Analyticity” in Rudolf Carnap, Logical Empiricist and Marco Mondadori’s introduction to Analiticità, Significanza, Induzione, in which Mondadori suggests a possible correction of Carnap’s definition.

With respect to inductive logic, I mention only Jaakko Hintikka’s generalization of Carnap’s continuum of inductive methods. In Carnap’s inductive logic, the probability of every universal law is always zero. Hintikka succeeded in formulating an inductive logic in which universal laws can obtain a positive degree of confirmation.

In Meaning and Necessity, 1947, Carnap was the first logician to use a semantic method to explain modalities. However, he used Tarskian model theory, so that every model of the language is an admissible model. In 1972 the American philosopher Saul Kripke was able to prove that a full semantics of modalities can be attained by means of possible-worlds semantics. According to Kripke, not all possible models are admissible. J. Hintikka’s essay “Carnap’s heritage in logical semantics” in Rudolf Carnap, Logical Empiricist, shows that Carnap came extremely close to possible-worlds semantics, but was not able to go beyond classical model theory.

The omega-rule, which Carnap proposed in The Logical Syntax of Language, has come into widespread use in metamathematical research over a broad range of subjects.

9. References and Further Reading

The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap (1963) contains the most complete bibliography of Carnap’s work. Listed below are Carnap’s most important works, arranged in chronological order.

a. Carnap’s Works

1922 Der Raum: Ein Beitrag zur Wissenschaftslehre, dissertation, in Kant-Studien, Ergänzungshefte, n. 56
1925 “Über die Abhängigkeit der Eigenschaften der Raumes von denen der Zeit” in Kant-Studien, 30
1926 Physikalische Begriffsbildung, Karlsruhe : Braun, (Wissen und Wirken ; 39)
1928 Scheinprobleme in der Philosophie, Berlin : Weltkreis-Verlag
1928 Der Logische Aufbau der Welt, Leipzig : Felix Meiner Verlag (English translation The Logical Structure of the World; Pseudoproblems in Philosophy, Berkeley : University of California Press, 1967)
1929 (with Otto Neurath and Hans Hahn) Wissenschaftliche Weltauffassung der Wiener Kreis, Vienna : A. Wolf
1929 Abriss der Logistik, mit besonderer Berücksichtigung der Relationstheorie und ihrer Anwendungen, Vienna : Springer
1932 “Die physikalische Sprache als Universalsprache der Wissenschaft” in Erkenntnis, II (English translation The Unity of Science, London : Kegan Paul, 1934)
1934 Logische Syntax der Sprache (English translation The Logical Syntax of Language, New York : Humanities, 1937)
1935 Philosophy and Logical Syntax, London : Kegan Paul
1936 “Testability and meaning” in Philosophy of Science, III (1936) and IV (1937)
1938 “Logical Foundations of the Unity of Science” in International Encyclopaedia of Unified Science, vol. I n. 1, Chicago : University of Chicago Press
1939 “Foundations of Logic and Mathematics” in International Encyclopaedia of Unified Science, vol. I n. 3, Chicago : University of Chicago Press
1942 Introduction to Semantics, Cambridge, Mass. : Harvard University Press
1943 Formalization of Logic, Cambridge, Mass. : Harvard University Press
1947 Meaning and Necessity: a Study in Semantics and Modal Logic, Chicago : University of Chicago Press
1950 Logical Foundations of Probability, Chicago : University of Chicago Press
1952 “Meaning postulates” in Philosophical Studies, III (now in Meaning and Necessity, 1956, 2nd edition)
1952 The Continuum of Inductive Methods, Chicago : University of Chicago Press
1954 Einführung in die Symbolische Logik, Vienna : Springer (English translation Introduction to Symbolic Logic and its Applications, New York : Dover, 1958)
1956 “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” in Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. I, ed. by H. Feigl and M. Scriven, Minneapolis : University of Minnesota Press
1958 “Beobacthungssprache und theoretische Sprache” in Dialectica, XII (English translation “Observation Language and Theoretical Language” in Rudolf Carnap, Logical Empiricist, Dordrecht, Holl. : D. Reidel Publishing Company, 1975)
1966 Philosophical Foundations of Physics, ed. by Martin Gardner, New York : Basic Books
1977 Two Essays on Entropy, ed. by Abner Shimony, Berkeley : University of California Press

b. Other Sources

1962 Logic and Language: Studies Dedicated to Professor Rudolf Carnap on the Occasion of his Seventieth Birthday, Dordrect, Holl. : D. Reidel Publishing Company
1963 The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap, ed. by Paul Arthur Schillp, La Salle, Ill. : Open Court Pub. Co.
1970 PSA 1970: Proceedings of the 1970 Biennial Meeting of the Philosophy of Science Association: In Memory of Rudolf Carnap, Dordrect, Holl. : D. Reidel Publishing Company
1971 Analiticità, Significanza, Induzione, ed. by Alberto Meotti e Marco Mondadori, Bologna, Italy : il Mulino
1975 Rudolf Carnap, Logical Empiricist. Materials and Perspectives, ed. by Jaakko Hintikka, Dordrecht, Holl. : D. Reidel Publishing Company
1986 Joëlle Proust, Questions de Forme: Logique at Proposition Analytique de Kant a Carnap, Paris, France: Fayard (English translation Questions of Forms: Logic and Analytic Propositions from Kant to Carnap, Minneapolis : University of Minnesota Press)
1990 Dear Carnap, Dear Van: The Quine-Carnap Correspondence and Related Work, ed. by Richard Creath, Berkeley : University of California Press
1991 Maria Grazia Sandrini, Probabilità e Induzione: Carnap e la Conferma come Concetto Semantico, Milano, Italy : Franco Angeli
1991 Erkenntnis Orientated: A Centennial Volume for Rudolf Carnap and Hans Reichenbach, ed. by Wolfgang Spohn, Dordrecht; Boston : Kluwer Academic Publishers
1991 Logic, Language, and the Structure of Scientific Theories: Proceedings of the Carnap-Reichenbach Centennial, University of Konstanz, 21-24 May 1991 Pittsburgh : University of Pittsburgh Press; [Konstanz] : Universitasverlag Konstanz
1995 L’eredità di Rudolf Carnap: Epistemologia, Filosofia delle Scienze, Filosofia del Linguaggio, ed. by Alberto Pasquinelli, Bologna, Italy : CLUEB

Author Information

Mauro Murzi
Email: murzim@yahoo.com
Italy

∴	A ⊃ ☐A A ⊃ ~◊~A	}	If A is true, then A must be true. If A is true, then A cannot be false.
	A ⊃ ☐~B A ⊃ ~◊B	}	If A is true, then B must be false.If A is true, then B cannot be true.
	B ⊃ ☐B B ⊃ ~◊~B	}	If B is true, then B must be true. If B is true, then B cannot be false.
	B ⊃ ☐~A B ⊃ ~◊A	}	If B is true, then A must be false.If B is true, then A cannot be true.

Alfred Schutz (1899—1959)

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works

2. Phenomenological Philosophy of the Social Sciences

3. References and Further Reading

Author Information

The Epistemology of Perception

Table of Contents

1. Perception and Belief

a. Seeing That, Seeing As and Simple Seeing

b. Perceptual Beliefs

2. Perception, Justification and Causation

a. Armstrong’s Causal Account of Perceptual Knowledge

3. Perception and Foundationalism

a. Traditional Foundationalism

b. Sellars and the Myth of the Given

c. Concepts and Experience

d. Modest Foundationalism

4. Perception and Coherentism

a. The Basic Idea Behind Coherentism

b. Bonjour and the Spontaneous Nature of Perceptual Beliefs

5. Externalism

6. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Johann Christian Friedrich Hölderlin (1770—1843)

Table of Contents

1. Overview

2. Life and Philosophical Background

3. Unity and Freedom

4. The Self and Human Life

5. Hölderlin’s Influence

6. Conclusion

7. References and Further Reading

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Religious Epistemology

Table of Contents

1. Reason/Rationality

2. The Evidentialist Objection to Belief in God

3. The Reasonableness of Belief in God

a. Theistic Evidentialism

b. Sociological Digression

c. Moral Analogy

d. Reformed Epistemology

e. Religious Experience

f. Internalism/Externalism

g. The Rational Stance

h. Objections to Reformed Epistemology

4. Groundless Believing

5. Conclusion

6. References and Further Reading

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Truth

Table of Contents

1. The Principal Problem

2. What Sorts of Things are True (or False)?

a. Ontological Issues

b. Constraints on Truth and Falsehood

c. Which Sentences Express Propositions?

d. Problem Cases

3. Correspondence Theory

4. Tarski’s Semantic Theory

a. Extending the Semantic Theory Beyond “Simple” Propositions

b. Can the Semantic Theory Account for Necessary Truth?

c. The Linguistic Theory of Necessary Truth

5. Coherence Theories

a. Postmodernism: The Most Recent Coherence Theory

6. Pragmatic Theories

7. Deflationary Theories

a. Redundancy Theory

b. Performative Theory

c. Prosentential Theory

8. Related Issues

a. Beyond Truth to Knowledge

b. Algorithms for Truth

c. Can “is true” be Eliminated?

d. Can a Theory of Truth Avoid Paradox?

e. Is The Goal of Scientific Research to Achieve Truth?

9. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Toleration