Pragmatism

Pragmatism is a philosophical movement that includes those who claim that an ideology or proposition is true if it works satisfactorily, that the meaning of a proposition is to be found in the practical consequences of accepting it, and that unpractical ideas are to be rejected. Pragmatism originated in the United States during the latter quarter of the nineteenth century. Although it has significantly influenced non-philosophers—notably in the fields of law, education, politics, sociology, psychology, and literary criticism—this article deals with it only as a movement within philosophy.

The term “pragmatism” was first used in print to designate a philosophical outlook about a century ago when William James (1842-1910) pressed the word into service during an 1898 address entitled “Philosophical Conceptions and Practical Results,” delivered at the University of California (Berkeley). James scrupulously swore, however, that the term had been coined almost three decades earlier by his compatriot and friend C. S. Peirce (1839-1914). (Peirce, eager to distinguish his doctrines from the views promulgated by James, later relabeled his own position “pragmaticism”—a name, he said, “ugly enough to be safe from kidnappers.”) The third major figure in the classical pragmatist pantheon is John Dewey (1859-1952), whose wide-ranging writings had considerable impact on American intellectual life for a half-century. After Dewey, however, pragmatism lost much of its momentum.

There has been a recent resurgence of interest in pragmatism, with several high-profile philosophers exploring and selectively appropriating themes and ideas embedded in the rich tradition of Peirce, James, and Dewey. While the best-known and most controversial of these so-called “neo-pragmatists” is Richard Rorty, the following contemporary philosophers are often considered to be pragmatists: Hilary Putnam, Nicholas Rescher, Jürgen Habermas, Susan Haack, Robert Brandom, and Cornel West.

The article’s first section contains an outline of the history of pragmatism; the second, a selective survey of themes and theses of the pragmatists.

A Pragmatist Who’s Who: An Historical Overview
1. Classical Pragmatism: From Peirce to Dewey
2. Post-Deweyan Pragmatism: From Quine to Rorty
Some Pragmatist Themes and Theses
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. A Pragmatist Who’s Who: An Historical Overview

a. Classical Pragmatism: From Peirce to Dewey

In the beginning was “The Metaphysical Club,” a group of a dozen Harvard-educated men who met for informal philosophical discussions during the early 1870s in Cambridge, Massachusetts. Club members included proto-positivist Chauncey Wright (1830-1875), future Supreme Court Justice Oliver Wendell Holmes (1841-1935), and two then-fledgling philosophers who went on to become the first self-conscious pragmatists: Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914), a logician, mathematician, and scientist; and William James (1842-1910), a psychologist and moralist armed with a medical degree.

Peirce summarized his own contributions to the Metaphysical Club’s meetings in two articles now regarded as founding documents of pragmatism: “The Fixation of Belief” (1877) and “How To Make Our Ideas Clear” (1878). James followed Peirce with his first philosophical essay, “Remarks on Spencer’s Definition of Mind as Correspondence,” (1878). After the appearance of The Principles of Psychology (1890), James went on to publish The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy (1896), The Varieties of Religious Experience (1902), Pragmatism: A New Name for Some Old Ways of Thinking (1907), and The Meaning of Truth: A Sequel to Pragmatism (1909). Peirce, unfortunately, never managed to publish a magnum opus in which his nuanced philosophical views were systematically expounded. Still, publish he did, though he left behind a mountain of manuscript fragments, many of which only made it into print decades after his death.

Peirce and James traveled different paths, philosophically as well as professionally. James, less rigorous but more concrete, became an esteemed public figure (and a Harvard professor) thanks to his intellectual range, his broad sympathies, and his Emersonian genius for edifying popularization. He recognized Peirce’s enormous creative gifts and did what he could to advance his friend professionally; but ultimately to no avail. Professional success within academe eluded Peirce; after his scandal-shrouded dismissal from Johns Hopkins University (1879-1884)—his sole academic appointment—he toiled in isolation in rural Pennsylvania. True, Peirce was not entirely cut off: he corresponded with colleagues, reviewed books, and delivered the odd invited lecture. Nevertheless, his philosophical work grew increasingly in-grown, and remained largely unappreciated by his contemporaries. The well-connected James, in contrast, regularly derived inspiration and stimulation from a motley assortment of fellow-travellers, sympathizers, and acute critics. These included members of the Chicago school of pragmatists, led by John Dewey (of whom more anon); Oxford’s acerbic iconoclast F.C.S. Schiller (1864-1937), a self-described Protagorean and “humanist”; Giovanni Papini (1881-1956), leader of a cell of Italian pragmatists; and two of James’s younger Harvard colleagues, the absolute idealist Josiah Royce (1855-1916) and the poetic naturalist George Santayana (1864-1952), both of whom challenged pragmatism while being influenced by it. (It should be noted, however, that Royce was also significantly influenced by Peirce.)

The final member of the classical pragmatist triumvirate is John Dewey (1859-1952), who had been a graduate student at Johns Hopkins during Peirce’s brief tenure there. In an illustrious career spanning seven decades, Dewey did much to make pragmatism (or “instrumentalism,” as he called it) respectable among professional philosophers. Peirce had been persona non grata in the academic world; James, an insider but no pedant, abhorred “the PhD Octopus” and penned eloquent lay sermons; but Dewey was a professor who wrote philosophy as professors were supposed to do—namely, for other professors. His mature works—Reconstruction in Philosophy (1920), Experience and Nature (1925), and The Quest for Certainty (1929)—boldly deconstruct the dualisms and dichotomies which, in one guise or another, had underwritten philosophy since the Greeks. According to Dewey, once philosophers give up these time-honoured distinctions—between appearance and reality, theory and practice, knowledge and action, fact and value—they will see through the ill-posed problems of traditional epistemology and metaphysics. Instead of trying to survey the world sub specie aeternitatis, Deweyan philosophers are content to keep their feet planted on terra firma and address “the problems of men.”

Dewey emerged as a major figure during his decade at the University of Chicago, where fellow pragmatist G.H. Mead (1863-1931) was a colleague and collaborator. After leaving Chicago for Columbia University in 1904, Dewey became even more prolific and influential; as a result, pragmatism became an important feature of the philosophical landscape at home and abroad. Dewey, indeed, had disciples and imitators aplenty; what he lacked was a bona fide successor—someone, that is, who could stand to Dewey as he himself stood to James and Peirce. It is therefore not surprising that by the 1940s—shortly after the publication of Dewey’s Logic: The Theory of Inquiry (1938)—pragmatism had lost much of its momentum and prestige.

This is not to say that pragmatists became an extinct species; C. I. Lewis (1883-1964) and Sidney Hook (1902-1989), for instance, remained prominent and productive. But to many it must have seemed that there was no longer much point in calling oneself a pragmatist—especially with the arrival of that self-consciously rigorous import, analytic philosophy. As American philosophers read more and more of Moore, Russell, Wittgenstein, and the Vienna Circle, many of them found the once-provocative dicta of Dewey and James infuriatingly vague and hazy. The age of grand synoptic philosophizing was drawing rapidly to a close; the age of piecemeal problem-solving and hard-edged argument was getting underway.

b. Post-Deweyan Pragmatism: From Quine to Rorty

And so it was that Deweyans were undone by the very force that had sustained them, namely, the progressive professionalization of philosophy as a specialized academic discipline. Pragmatism, once touted as America’s distinctive gift to Western philosophy, was soon unjustly derided by many rank-and-file analysts as passé. Of the original pragmatist triumvirate, Peirce fared the best by far; indeed, some analytic philosophers were so impressed by his technical contributions to logic and the philosophy of science that they paid him the (dubious) compliment of re-making him in their own image. But the reputations of James and Dewey suffered greatly and the influence of pragmatism as a faction waned. True, W.V.O. Quine´s (1908-2000) landmark article “Two Dogmas of Empiricism” (1951) challenged positivist orthodoxy by drawing on the legacy of pragmatism. However, despite Quine’s qualified enthusiasm for parts of that legacy—an enthusiasm shared in varying degrees by Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889-1951), Rudolf Carnap (1891-1970), Hans Reichenbach (1891-1953), Karl Popper (1902-1994), F.P. Ramsey (1903-1930), Nelson Goodman (1906-1999), Wilfrid Sellars (1912-1989), and Thomas Kuhn (1922-1996)—mainstream analytic philosophers tended to ignore pragmatism until the early 1980s.

What got philosophers talking about pragmatism again was the publication of Richard Rorty’s Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature (1979)—a controversial tome which repudiated the basic presuppositions of modern philosophy with élan, verve, and learning. Declaring epistemology a lost cause, Rorty found inspiration and encouragement in Dewey; for Dewey, Rorty pleaded, had presciently seen that philosophy must become much less Platonist and less Kantian—less concerned, that is, with unearthing necessary and ahistorical normative foundations for our culture’s practices. Once we understand our culture not as a static edifice but as an on-going conversation, the philosopher’s official job description changes from foundation-layer to interpreter. In the absence of an Archimedean point, philosophy can only explore our practices and vocabularies from within; it can neither ground them on something external nor assess them for representational accuracy. Post-epistemological philosophy accordingly becomes the art of understanding; it explores the ways in which those voices which constitute that mutable conversation we call our culture—the voices of science, art, morality, religion, and the like—are related.

In subsequent writings—Consequences of Pragmatism (1982), Contingency, Irony, and Solidarity (1989), Achieving Our Country (1998), Philosophy and Social Hope (1999), and three volumes of Philosophical Papers (1991, 1991, 1998)—Rorty has enthusiastically identified himself as a pragmatist; in addition, he has urged that this epithet can be usefully bestowed on a host of other well-known philosophers—notably Donald Davidson (1917-2003). Though Rorty is the most visible and vocal contemporary champion of pragmatism, many other well-known figures have contributed significantly to the resurgence of this many-sided movement. Prominent revivalists include Karl-Otto Apel (b. 1922), Israel Scheffler (b. 1923), Joseph Margolis (b. 1924), Hilary Putnam (b. 1926), Nicholas Rescher (b. 1928), Jürgen Habermas (b. 1929), Richard Bernstein (b. 1932), Stephen Stich (b. 1944), Susan Haack (b. 1945), Robert Brandom (b. 1950), Cornel West (b. 1953), and Cheryl Misak (b. 1961). There is much disagreement among these writers, however, so it would be grossly misleading to present them as manifesto-signing members of a single sect or clique.

2. Some Pragmatist Themes and Theses

What makes these philosophers pragmatists? There is, alas, no simple answer to this question. For there is no pragmatist creed; that is, no neat list of articles or essential tenets endorsed by all pragmatists and only by pragmatists. Nevertheless, it is possible to identify certain ideas that have loomed large in the pragmatist tradition—though that is not to say that these ideas are the exclusive property of pragmatists, nor that they are endorsed by all pragmatists.

Here, then, are some themes and theses to which many pragmatists have been attached.

a. A Method and A Maxim

Pragmatism may be presented as a way of clarifying (and in some cases dissolving) intractable metaphysical and epistemological disputes. According to the down-to-earth pragmatist, bickering metaphysicians should get in the habit of posing the following question: “What concrete practical difference would it make if my theory were true and its rival(s) false?” Where there is no such difference, there is no genuine (that is, non-verbal) disagreement, and hence no genuine problem.

This method is closely connected to the so-called “pragmatic maxim,” different versions of which were formulated by Peirce and James in their attempts to clarify the meaning of abstract concepts or ideas. This maxim points to a broadly verificationist conception of linguistic meaning according to which no sense can be made of the idea that there are facts which are unknowable in principle (that is, truths which no one could ever be warranted in asserting and which could have absolutely no bearing on our conduct or experience). From this point of view, talk of inaccessible Kantian things-in-themselves—of a “True World” (Nietzsche) forever hidden behind the veil of phenomena—is useless or idle. In a sense, then, the maxim-wielding pragmatist agrees with Oscar Wilde: only shallow people do not judge by appearances.

Moreover, theories and models are to be judged primarily by their fruits and consequences, not by their origins or their relations to antecedent data or facts. The basic idea is presented metaphorically by James and Dewey, for whom scientific theories are instruments or tools for coping with reality. As Dewey emphasized, the utility of a theory is a matter of its problem-solving power; pragmatic coping must not be equated with what delivers emotional consolation or subjective comfort. What is essential is that theories pay their way in the long run—that they can be relied upon time and again to solve pressing problems and to clear up significant difficulties confronting inquirers. To the extent that a theory functions or “works” practically in this way, it makes sense to keep using it—though we must always allow for the possibility that it will eventually have to be replaced by some theory that works even better. (See Section 2b below, for more on fallibilism.) An intriguing variant on this theme can arguably be found in Popper’s falsificationist philosophy of science: though never positively justified, theories (understood as bold conjectures or guesses) may still be rationally accepted provided repeated attempts to falsify them have failed.

b. Anti-Cartesianism

From Peirce and James to Rorty and Davidson, pragmatists have consistently sought to purify empiricism of vestiges of Cartesianism. They have insisted, for instance, that empiricism divest itself of that understanding of the mental which Locke, Berkeley, and Hume inherited from Descartes. According to such Cartesianism, the mind is a self-contained sphere whose contents—“ideas” or “impressions”—are irredeemably subjective and private, and utterly sundered from the public and objective world they purport to represent. Once we accept this picture of the mind as a world unto itself, we must confront a host of knotty problems—about solipsism, skepticism, realism, and idealism—with which empiricists have long struggled. Pragmatists have expressed their opposition to this Cartesian picture in many ways: Peirce´s view that beliefs are rules for action; James’s teleological understanding of the mind; Dewey’s Darwinian-inflected ruminations on experience; Popper’s mockery of the “bucket theory of the mind”; Wittgenstein’s private language argument; Rorty’s refusal to view the mind as Nature’s mirror; and Davidson’s critique of “the myth of the subjective.” In these and other cases, the intention is emancipatory: pragmatists see themselves as freeing philosophy from optional assumptions which have generated insoluble and unreal problems.

Pragmatists also find the Cartesian “quest for certainty” (Dewey) quixotic. Pace Descartes, no statement or judgment about the world is absolutely certain or incorrigible. All beliefs and theories are best treated as working hypotheses which may need to be modified—refined, revised, or rejected—in light of future inquiry and experience. Pragmatists have defended such fallibilism by means of various arguments; here are sketches of five: (1) There is an argument from the history of inquiry: even our best, most impressive theories—Euclidean geometry and Newtonian physics, for instance—have needed significant and unexpected revisions. (2) If scientific theories are dramatically underdetermined by data, then there are alternative theories which fit said data. How then can we be absolutely sure we have chosen the right theory? (3) If we say (with Peirce) that the truth is what would be accepted at the end of inquiry, it seems we cannot be absolutely certain that an opinion of ours is true unless we know with certainty that we have reached the end of inquiry. But how could we ever know that? (See Section 2e below for more on Peirce’s theory of truth.) (4) There is a methodological argument as well: ascriptions of certainty block the road of inquiry, because they may keep us from making progress (that is, finding a better view or theory) should progress still be possible. (5) Finally, there is a political argument. Fallibilism, it is said, is the only sane alternative to a cocksure dogmatism, and to the fanaticism, intolerance, and violence to which such dogmatism can all too easily lead.

Pragmatists have also inveighed against the Cartesian idea that philosophy should begin with bold global doubt—that is, a doubt capable of demolishing all our old beliefs. Peirce, James, Dewey, Quine, Popper, and Rorty, for example, have all emphatically denied that we must wipe the slate clean and find some neutral, necessary or presuppositionless starting-point for inquiry. Inquiry, pragmatists are persuaded, can start only when there is some actual or living doubt; but, they point out, we cannot genuinely doubt everything at once (though they allow, as good fallibilists should, that there is nothing which we may not come to doubt in the course of our inquiries). This anti-Cartesian attitude is summed up by Otto Neurath’s celebrated metaphor of the conceptual scheme as raft: inquirers are mariners who must repair their raft plank by plank, adrift all the while on the open sea; for they can never disembark and scrutinize their craft in dry-dock from an external standpoint. In sum, we must begin in media res—in the middle of things—and confess that our starting-points are contingent and historically conditioned inheritances. One meta-philosophical moral drawn by Dewey (and seconded by Quine) was that we should embrace naturalism: the idea that philosophy is not prior to science, but continuous with it. There is thus no special, distinctive method on which philosophers as a caste can pride themselves; no transcendentalist faculty of pure Reason or Intuition; no Reality (immutable or otherwise) inaccessible to science for philosophy to ken or limn. Moreover, philosophers do not invent or legislate standards from on high; instead, they make explicit the norms and methods implicit in our best current practice.

Finally, it should be noted that pragmatists are unafraid of the Cartesian global skeptic—that is, the kind of skeptic who contends that we cannot know anything about the external world because we can never know that we are not merely dreaming. They have urged that such skepticism is merely a reductio ad absurdum of the futile quest for certainty (Dewey, Rescher); that skepticism rests on an untenable Cartesian philosophy of mind (Rorty, Davidson); that skepticism presupposes a discredited correspondence theory of truth (Rorty); that the belief in an external world is justified insofar as it “works,” or best explains our sensory experience (James, Schiller, Quine); that the problem of the external world is bogus, since it cannot be formulated unless it is already assumed that there is an external world (Dewey); that the thought that there are truths no one could ever know is empty (Peirce); and that massive error about the world is simply inconceivable (Putnam, Davidson).

c. The Kantian Inheritance

Pragmatism’s critique of Cartesianism and empiricism draws heavily—though not uncritically—on Kant. Pragmatists typically think, for instance, that Kant was right to say that the world must be interpreted with the aid of a scheme of basic categories; but, they add, he was dead wrong to suggest that this framework is somehow sacrosanct, immutable, or necessary. Our categories and theories are indeed our creations; they reflect our peculiar constitution and history, and are not simply read off from the world. But frameworks can change and be replaced. And just as there is more than one way to skin a cat, there is more than one sound way to conceptualize the world and its content. Which interpretative framework or vocabulary we should use—that of physics, say, or common sense—will depend on our purposes and interests in a given context.

The upshot of all this is that the world does not impose some unique description on us; rather, it is we who choose how the world is to be described. Though this idea is powerfully present in James, it is also prominent in later pragmatism. It informs Carnap’s distinction between internal and external questions, Rorty’s claim that Nature has no preferred description of itself, Goodman’s talk of world-making and of right but incompatible world-versions, and Putnam’s insistence that objects exist relative to conceptual schemes or frameworks.

Then there is the matter of appealing to raw experience as a source of evidence for our beliefs. According to the tradition of mainstream empiricism from Locke to Ayer, our beliefs about the world ultimately derive their justification from perception. What then justifies one’s belief that the cat is on the mat? Not another belief or judgment, but simply one’s visual experience: one sees said cat cavorting on said mat—and that is that. Since experience is simply “given” to the mind from without, it can justify one’s basic beliefs (that is, beliefs that are justified but whose justification does not derive from any other beliefs). Sellars, Rorty, Davidson, Putnam, and Goodman are perhaps the best-known pragmatist opponents of this foundationalist picture. Drawing inspiration from Kant’s dictum that “intuitions without concepts are blind,” they aver that to perceive is really to interpret and hence to classify. But if observation is theory-laden—if, that is, epistemic access to reality is necessarily mediated by concepts and descriptions—then we cannot verify theories or worldviews by comparing them with some raw, unsullied sensuous “Given.” Hence old-time empiricists were fundamentally mistaken: experience cannot serve as a basic, belief-independent source of justification.

More generally, pragmatists from Peirce to Rorty have been suspicious of foundationalist theories of justification according to which empirical knowledge ultimately rests on an epistemically privileged basis—that is, on a class of foundational beliefs which justify or support all other beliefs but which depend on no other beliefs for their justification. Their objections to such theories are many: that so-called “immediate” (or non-inferential) knowledge is a confused fiction; that knowledge is more like a coherent web than a hierarchically structured building; that there are no certain foundations for knowledge (since fallibilism is true); that foundational beliefs cannot be justified by appealing to perceptual experience (since the “Given” is a myth); and that knowledge has no overall or non-contextual structure whatsoever.

d. Against the Spectator Theory of Knowledge

Pragmatists resemble Kant in yet another respect: they, too, ferociously repudiate the Lockean idea that the mind resembles either a blank slate (on which Nature impresses itself) or a dark chamber (into which the light of experience streams). What these august metaphors seem intended to convey (among other things) is the idea that observation is pure reception, and that the mind is fundamentally passive in perception. From the pragmatist standpoint this is just one more lamentable incarnation of what Dewey dubbed “the spectator theory of knowledge.” According to spectator theorists (who range from Plato to modern empiricists), knowing is akin to seeing or beholding. Here, in other words, the knower is envisioned as a peculiar kind of voyeur: her aim is to reflect or duplicate the world without altering it—to survey or contemplate things from a practically disengaged and disinterested standpoint.

Not so, says Dewey. For Dewey, Peirce, and like-minded pragmatists, knowledge (or warranted assertion) is the product of inquiry, a problem-solving process by means of which we move from doubt to belief. Inquiry, however, cannot proceed effectively unless we experiment—that is, manipulate or change reality in certain ways. Since knowledge thus grows through our attempts to push the world around (and see what happens as a result), it follows that knowers as such must be agents; as a result, the ancient dualism between theory and practice must go by the board. This insight is central to the “experimental theory of knowledge,” which is Dewey’s alternative to the discredited spectatorial conception.

This repudiation of the passivity of observation is a major theme in pragmatist epistemology. According to James and Dewey, for instance, to observe is to select—to be on the lookout for something, be it for a needle in a haystack or a friendly face in a crowd. Hence our perceptions and observations do not reflect Nature with passive impartiality; first, because observers are bound to discriminate, guided by interest, expectation, and theory; second, because we cannot observe unless we act. But if experience is inconceivable apart from human interests and agency, then perceivers are truly explorers of the world—not mirrors superfluously reproducing it. And if acceptance of some theory or other always precedes and directs observation, we must break with the classical empiricist assumption that theories are derived from independently discovered data or facts.

Again, it is proverbial that facts are stubborn things. If we want to find out how things really are, we are counseled by somber common-sense to open our eyes (literally as well as figuratively) and take a gander at the world; facts accessible to observation will then impress themselves on us, forcing their way into our minds whether we are prepared to extend them a hearty welcome or not. Facts, so understood, are the antidote to prejudice and the cure for bias; their epistemic authority is so powerful that it cannot be overridden or resisted. This idea is a potent and reassuring one, but it is apt to mislead. According to holists such as James and Schiller, the justificatory status of beliefs is partly a function of how well they cohere or fit with entrenched beliefs or theory. Since the range of “facts” we can countenance or acknowledge is accordingly constrained by our body of previous acquired beliefs, no “fact” can be admitted into our minds unless it can be coherently assimilated or harmonized with beliefs we already hold. This amounts to a rejection of Locke’s suggestion that the mind is a blank slate, that is, a purely receptive and patient tabula rasa.

e. Beyond The Correspondence Theory of Truth

According to a longstanding tradition running from Plato to the present-day, truth is a matter of correspondence or agreement with reality (or with the aforementioned “facts”). But this venerable view is vague and beset with problems, say pragmatists. Here are just four: (1) How is this mysterious relation called “correspondence” to be understood or explicated? Not as copying, surely; but then how? (2) The correspondence theory makes a mystery of our practices of verification and inquiry. For we cannot know whether our beliefs are correspondence-true: if the “Given” is a myth, we cannot justify theories by comparing them with an unconceptualized reality. (3) It has seemed to some that traditional correspondence theories are committed to the outmoded Cartesian picture of the mind as Nature’s mirror, in which subjective inner representations of an objective outer order are formed. (4) It has also been urged that there is no extra-linguistic reality for us to represent—no mind-independent world to which our beliefs are answerable. What sense, then, can be made of the suggestion that true thoughts correspond to thought-independent things?

Some pragmatists have concluded that the correspondence theory is positively mistaken and must be abandoned. Others, more cautious, merely insist that standard formulations of the theory are uninformative or incomplete. Schiller, Rorty, and Putnam all arguably belong to the former group; Peirce, James, Dewey, Rescher, and Davidson, to the latter.

Apart from criticizing the correspondence theory, what have pragmatists had to say about truth? Here three views must be mentioned: (1) James and Dewey are often said to have held the view that the truth is what “works”: true hypotheses are useful, and vice versa. This view is easy to caricature and traduce—until the reader attends carefully to the subtle pragmatist construal of utility. (What James and Dewey had in mind here was discussed above in Section 2a.) (2) According to Peirce, true opinions are those which inquirers will accept at the end of inquiry (that is, views on which we could not improve, no matter how far inquiry on that subject is pressed or pushed). Peirce’s basic approach has inspired later pragmatists such as Putnam (whose “internal realism” glosses truth as ideal rational acceptability) as well as Apel and Habermas (who have equated truth with what would be accepted by all in an ideal speech situation). (3) According to Rorty, truth has no nature or essence; hence the less said about it, the better. To call a belief or theory “true” is not to ascribe any property to it; it is merely to perform some speech act (for example, to recommend, to caution, etc.). As Rorty sees it, his fellow pragmatists—James, Dewey, Peirce, Putnam, Habermas, and Apel—all err in thinking that truth can be elucidated or explicated.

3. Conclusion

For the most part, pragmatists have thought of themselves as reforming the tradition of empiricism—though some have gone further and recommended that tradition’s abolition. As this difference of opinion suggests, pragmatists do not vote en bloc. There is no such thing as the pragmatist party-line: not only have pragmatists taken different views on major issues (for example, truth, realism, skepticism, perception, justification, fallibilism, realism, conceptual schemes, the function of philosophy, etc.), they have also disagreed about what the major issues are. While such diversity may seem commendably in keeping with pragmatism’s professed commitment to pluralism, detractors have urged it only goes to show that pragmatism stands for little or nothing in particular. This gives rise to a question as awkward as it is unavoidable—namely, how useful is the term “pragmatism”? That question is wide open.

4. References and Further Reading

Borradori, G. (Ed.) The American Philosopher. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1994.
Flower, E. and Murphey, M. A History of Philosophy in America. New York: Putnam, 1997.
Kuklick, B. A History of Philosophy in America: 1720-2000. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002.
McDermid, D. The Varieties of Pragmatism: Truth, Realism, and Knowledge from James to Rorty. London and New York: Continuum, 2006.
Menand, L. The Metaphysical Club: A Story of Ideas in America. New York: Farrar Straus Giroux, 2001.
Murphy, J. Pragmatism: From Peirce to Davidson. Boulder: Westview Press, 1990.
Scheffler, I. Four Pragmatists: A Critical Introduction to Peirce, James, Mead, and Dewey. London and New York: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1986.
Shook, J. and Margolis, J. (Eds.) A Companion to Pragmatism. Oxford: Blackwell, 2006.
Stuhr, J. (Ed.) Pragmatism and Classical American Philosophy: Essential Readings and Interpretive Essays. New York: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Thayer, H.S. Meaning and Action: A Critical History of Pragmatism. 2nd ed. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1981.
West, C. The American Evasion of Philosophy: A Genealogy of Pragmatism. Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 1989.

Author Information

Douglas McDermid
Email: dmcdermi@trentu.ca
Trent University
Canada

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy