Act and Rule Utilitarianism
Utilitarianism is one of the best known and most influential moral theories. Like other forms of consequentialism, its core idea is that whether actions are morally right or wrong depends on their effects. More specifically, the only effects of actions that are relevant are the good and bad results that they produce. A key point in this article concerns the distinction between individual actions and types of actions. Act utilitarians focus on the effects of individual actions (such as John Wilkes Booth’s assassination of Abraham Lincoln) while rule utilitarians focus on the effects of types of actions (such as killing or stealing).
Utilitarians believe that the purpose of morality is to make life better by increasing the amount of good things (such as pleasure and happiness) in the world and decreasing the amount of bad things (such as pain and unhappiness). They reject moral codes or systems that consist of commands or taboos that are based on customs, traditions, or orders given by leaders or supernatural beings. Instead, utilitarians think that what makes a morality be true or justifiable is its positive contribution to human (and perhaps non-human) beings.
The most important classical utilitarians are Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832) and John Stuart Mill (1806-1873). Bentham and Mill were both important theorists and social reformers. Their theory has had a major impact both on philosophical work in moral theory and on approaches to economic, political, and social policy. Although utilitarianism has always had many critics, there are many 21st century thinkers that support it.
The task of determining whether utilitarianism is the correct moral theory is complicated because there are different versions of the theory, and its supporters disagree about which version is correct. This article focuses on perhaps the most important dividing line among utilitarians, the clash between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism. After a brief overall explanation of utilitarianism, the article explains both act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism, the main differences between them, and some of the key arguments for and against each view.
Table of Contents
- Utilitarianism: Overall View
- How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ
- Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
- Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
- Conclusion
- References and Further Reading
1. Utilitarianism: Overall View
Utilitarianism is a philosophical view or theory about how we should evaluate a wide range of things that involve choices that people face. Among the things that can be evaluated are actions, laws, policies, character traits, and moral codes. Utilitarianism is a form of consequentialism because it rests on the idea that it is the consequences or results of actions, laws, policies, etc. that determine whether they are good or bad, right or wrong. In general, whatever is being evaluated, we ought to choose the one that will produce the best overall results. In the language of utilitarians, we should choose the option that “maximizes utility,” i.e. that action or policy that produces the largest amount of good.
Utilitarianism appears to be a simple theory because it consists of only one evaluative principle: Do what produces the best consequences. In fact, however, the theory is complex because we cannot understand that single principle unless we know (at least) three things: a) what things are good and bad; b) whose good (i.e. which individuals or groups) we should aim to maximize; and c) whether actions, policies, etc. are made right or wrong by their actual consequences (the results that our actions actually produce) or by their foreseeable consequences (the results that we predict will occur based on the evidence that we have).
a. What is Good?
Jeremy Bentham answered this question by adopting the view called hedonism. According to hedonism, the only thing that is good in itself is pleasure (or happiness). Hedonists do not deny that many different kinds of things can be good, including food, friends, freedom, and many other things, but hedonists see these as “instrumental” goods that are valuable only because they play a causal role in producing pleasure or happiness. Pleasure and happiness, however, are “intrinsic” goods, meaning that they are good in themselves and not because they produce some further valuable thing. Likewise, on the negative side, a lack of food, friends, or freedom is instrumentally bad because it produces pain, suffering, and unhappiness; but pain, suffering and unhappiness are intrinsically bad, i.e. bad in themselves and not because they produce some further bad thing.
Many thinkers have rejected hedonism because pleasure and pain are sensations that we feel, claiming that many important goods are not types of feelings. Being healthy or honest or having knowledge, for example, are thought by some people to be intrinsic goods that are not types of feelings. (People who think there are many such goods are called pluralists or“objective list” theorists.) Other thinkers see desires or preferences as the basis of value; whatever a person desires is valuable to that person. If desires conflict, then the things most strongly preferred are identified as good.
In this article, the term “well-being” will generally be used to identify what utilitarians see as good or valuable in itself. All utilitarians agree that things are valuable because they tend to produce well-being or diminish ill-being, but this idea is understood differently by hedonists, objective list theorists, and preference/desire theorists. This debate will not be further discussed in this article.
b. Whose Well-being?
Utilitarian reasoning can be used for many different purposes. It can be used both for moral reasoning and for any type of rational decision-making. In addition to applying in different contexts, it can also be used for deliberations about the interests of different persons and groups.
i. Individual Self-interest
(See egoism.) When individuals are deciding what to do for themselves alone, they consider only their own utility. For example, if you are choosing ice cream for yourself, the utilitarian view is that you should choose the flavor that will give you the most pleasure. If you enjoy chocolate but hate vanilla, you should choose chocolate for the pleasure it will bring and avoid vanilla because it will bring displeasure. In addition, if you enjoy both chocolate and strawberry, you should predict which flavor will bring you more pleasure and choose whichever one will do that.
In this case, because utilitarian reasoning is being applied to a decision about which action is best for an individual person, it focuses only on how the various possible choices will affect this single person’s interest and does not consider the interests of other people.
ii. Groups
People often need to judge what is best not only for themselves or other individuals but alsowhat is best for groups, such as friends, families, religious groups, one’s country, etc. Because Bentham and other utilitarians were interested in political groups and public policies, they often focused on discovering which actions and policies would maximize the well-being of the relevant group. Their method for determining the well-being of a group involved adding up the benefits and losses that members of the group would experience as a result of adopting one action or policy. The well-being of the group is simply the sum total of the interests of the all of its members.
To illustrate this method, suppose that you are buying ice cream for a party that ten people will attend. Your only flavor options are chocolate and vanilla, and some of the people attending like chocolate while others like vanilla. As a utilitarian, you should choose the flavor that will result in the most pleasure for the group as a whole. If seven like chocolate and three like vanilla and if all of them get the same amount of pleasure from the flavor they like, then you should choose chocolate. This will yield what Bentham, in a famous phrase, called “the greatest happiness for the greatest number.”
An important point in this case is that you should choose chocolate even if you are one of the three people who enjoy vanilla more than chocolate. The utilitarian method requires you to count everyone’s interests equally. You may not weigh some people’s interests—including your own—more heavily than others. Similarly, if a government is choosing a policy, it should give equal consideration to the well-being of all members of the society.
iii. Everyone Affected
While there are circumstances in which the utilitarian analysis focuses on the interests of specific individuals or groups, the utilitarian moral theory requires that moral judgments be based on what Peter Singer calls the “equal consideration of interests.” Utilitarianism moral theory then, includes the important idea that when we calculate the utility of actions, laws, or policies, we must do so from an impartial perspective and not from a “partialist” perspective that favors ourselves, our friends, or others we especially care about. Bentham is often cited as the source of a famous utilitarian axiom: “every man to count for one, nobody for more than one.”
If this impartial perspective is seen as necessary for a utilitarian morality, then both self-interest and partiality to specific groups will be rejected as deviations from utilitarian morality. For example, so-called “ethical egoism,” which says that morality requires people to promote their own interest, would be rejected either as a false morality or as not a morality at all. While a utilitarian method for determining what people’s interests are may show that it is rational for people to maximize their own well-being or the well-being of groups that they favor, utilitarian morality would reject this as a criterion for determining what is morally right or wrong.
c. Actual Consequences or Foreseeable Consequences?
Utilitarians disagree about whether judgments of right and wrong should be based on the actual consequences of actions or their foreseeable consequences. This issue arises when the actual effects of actions differ from what we expected. J. J. C. Smart (49) explains this difference by imagining the action of a person who, in 1938,saves someone from drowning. While we generally regard saving a drowning person as the right thing to do and praise people for such actions, in Smart’s imagined example, the person saved from drowning turns out to be Adolf Hitler. Had Hitler drowned, millions of other people might have been saved from suffering and death between 1938 and 1945. If utilitarianism evaluates the rescuer’s action based on its actual consequences, then the rescuer did the wrong thing. If, however, utilitarians judge the rescuer’s action by its foreseeable consequences (i.e. the ones the rescuer could reasonably predict), then the rescuer—who could not predict the negative effects of saving the person from drowning—did the right thing.
One reason for adopting foreseeable consequence utilitarianism is that it seems unfair to say that the rescuer acted wrongly because the rescuer could not foresee the future bad effects of saving the drowning person. In response, actual consequence utilitarians reply that there is a difference between evaluating an action and evaluating the person who did the action. In their view, while the rescuer’s action was wrong, it would be a mistake to blame or criticize the rescuer because the bad results of his act were unforeseeable. They stress the difference between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who perform them.
Foreseeable consequence utilitarians accept the distinction between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who carry them out, but they see no reason to make the moral rightness or wrongness of actions depend on facts that might be unknowable. For them, what is right or wrong for a person to do depends on what is knowable by a person at a time. For this reason, they claim that the person who rescued Hitler did the right thing, even though the actual consequences were unfortunate.
Another way to describe the actual vs. foreseeable consequence dispute is to contrast two thoughts. One (the actual consequence view) says that to act rightly is to do whatever produces the best consequences. The second view says that a person acts rightly by doing the action that has the highest level of “expected utility.” The expected utility is a combination of the good (or bad) effects that one predicts will result from an action and the probability of those effects occurring. In the case of the rescuer, the expected positive utility is high because the probability that saving a drowning person will lead to the deaths of millions of other people is extremely low, and thus can be ignored in deliberations about whether to save the drowning person.
What this shows is that actual consequence and foreseeable consequence utilitarians have different views about the nature of utilitarian theory. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians understand the theory as a decision-making procedure while actual consequence utilitarians understand it as a criterion of right and wrong. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians claim that the action with the highest expected utility is both the best thing to do based on current evidence and the right action. Actual consequence utilitarians might agree that the option with the highest expected utility is the best thing to do but they claim that it could still turn out to be the wrong action. This would occur if unforeseen bad consequences reveal that the option chosen did not have the best results and thus was the wrong thing to do.
2. How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ
Both act utilitarians and rule utilitarians agree that our overall aim in evaluating actions should be to create the best results possible, but they differ about how to do that.
Act utilitarians believe that whenever we are deciding what to do, we should perform the action that will create the greatest net utility. In their view, the principle of utility—do whatever will produce the best overall results—should be applied on a case by case basis. The right action in any situation is the one that yields more utility (i.e. creates more well-being) than other available actions.
Rule utilitarians adopt a two part view that stresses the importance of moral rules. According to rule utilitarians, a) a specific action is morally justified if it conforms to a justified moral rule; and b) a moral rule is justified if its inclusion into our moral code would create more utility than other possible rules (or no rule at all). According to this perspective, we should judge the morality of individual actions by reference to general moral rules, and we should judge particular moral rules by seeing whether their acceptance into our moral code would produce more well-being than other possible rules.
The key difference between act and rule utilitarianism is that act utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of individual actions while rule utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of rules and then evaluate individual actions by seeing if they obey or disobey those rules whose acceptance will produce the most utility.
The contrast between act and rule utilitarianism, though previously noted by some philosophers, was not sharply drawn until the late 1950s when Richard Brandt introduced this terminology. (Other terms that have been used to make this contrast are “direct” and “extreme” for act utilitarianism, and “indirect” and “restricted” for rule utilitarianism.) Because the contrast had not been sharply drawn, earlier utilitarians like Bentham and Mill sometimes apply the principle of utility to actions and sometimes apply it to the choice of rules for evaluating actions. This has led to scholarly debates about whether the classical utilitarians supported act utilitarians or rule utilitarians or some combination of these views. One indication that Mill accepted rule utilitarianism is his claim that direct appeal to the principle of utility is made only when “secondary principles” (i.e. rules) conflict with one another. In such cases, the “maximize utility” principle is used to resolve the conflict and determine the right action to take. [Mill, Utilitarianism, Chapter 2]
3. Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
Act utilitarianism is often seen as the most natural interpretation of the utilitarian ideal. If our aim is always to produce the best results, it seems plausible to think that in each case of deciding what is the right thing to do, we should consider the available options (i.e. what actions could be performed), predict their outcomes, and approve of the action that will produce the most good.
a. Arguments for Act Utilitarianism
i. Why Act utilitarianism Maximizes Utility
If every action that we carry out yields more utility than any other action available to us, then the total utility of all our actions will be the highest possible level of utility that we could bring about. In other words, we can maximize the overall utility that is within our power to bring about by maximizing the utility of each individual action that we perform. If we sometimes choose actions that produce less utility than is possible, the total utility of our actions will be less than the amount of goodness that we could have produced. For that reason, act utilitarians argue, we should apply the utilitarian principle to individual acts and not to classes of similar actions.
ii. Why Act Utilitarianism is Better than Traditional, Rule-based Moralities
Traditional moral codes often consist of sets of rules regarding types of actions. The Ten Commandments, for example, focus on types of actions, telling us not to kill, steal, bear false witness, commit adultery, or covet the things that belong to others. Although the Biblical sources permit exceptions to these rules (such as killing in self-defense and punishing people for their sins), the form of the commandments is absolute. They tell us “thou shalt not do x” rather than saying “thou shalt not do x except in circumstances a, b, or c.”
In fact, both customary and philosophical moral codes often seem to consist of absolute rules. The philosopher Immanuel Kant is famous for the view that lying is always wrong, even in cases where one might save a life by lying. According to Kant, if A is trying to murder B and A asks you where B is, it would be wrong for you to lie to A, even if lying would save B’s life (Kant).
Act utilitarians reject rigid rule-based moralities that identify whole classes of actions as right or wrong. They argue that it is a mistake to treat whole classes of actions as right or wrong because the effects of actions differ when they are done in different contexts and morality must focus on the likely effects of individual actions. It is these effects that determine whether they are right or wrong in specific cases. Act utilitarians acknowledge that it may be useful to have moral rules that are “rules of thumb”—i.e., rules that describe what is generally right or wrong, but they insist that whenever people can do more good by violating a rule rather than obeying it, they should violate the rule. They see no reason to obey a rule when more well-being can be achieved by violating it.
iii. Why Act Utilitarianism Makes Moral Judgments Objectively True
One advantage of act utilitarianism is that it shows how moral questions can have objectively true answers. Often, people believe that morality is subjective and depends only on people’s desires or sincere beliefs. Act utilitarianism, however, provides a method for showing which moral beliefs are true and which are false.
Once we embrace the act utilitarian perspective, then every decision about how we should act will depend on the actual or foreseeable consequences of the available options. If we can predict the amount of utility/good results that will be produced by various possible actions, then we can know which ones are right or wrong.
Although some people doubt that we can measure amounts of well-being, we in fact do this all the time. If two people are suffering and we have enough medication for only one, we can often tell that one person is experiencing mild discomfort while the other is in severe pain. Based on this judgment, we will be confident that we can do more good by giving the medication to the person suffering extreme pain. Although this case is very simple, it shows that we can have objectively true answers to questions about what actions are morally right or wrong.
Jeremy Bentham provided a model for this type of decision making in his description of a “hedonic calculus,” which was meant to show what factors should be used to determine amounts of pleasure and happiness, pain and suffering. Using this information, Bentham thought, would allow for making correct judgments both in individual cases and in choices about government actions and policies.
b. Arguments against Act Utilitarianism
i. The “Wrong Answers” Objection
The most common argument against act utilitarianism is that it gives the wrong answers to moral questions. Critics say that it permits various actions that everyone knows are morally wrong. The following cases are among the commonly cited examples:
- If a judge can prevent riots that will cause many deaths only by convicting an innocent person of a crime and imposing a severe punishment on that person, act utilitarianism implies that the judge should convict and punish the innocent person. (See Rawls and also Punishment.)
- If a doctor can save five people from death by killing one healthy person and using that person’s organs for life-saving transplants, then act utilitarianism implies that the doctor should kill the one person to save five.
- If a person makes a promise but breaking the promise will allow that person to perform an action that creates just slightly more well-being than keeping the promise will, then act utilitarianism implies that the promise should be broken. (See Ross)
The general form of each of these arguments is the same. In each case, act utilitarianism implies that a certain act is morally permissible or required. Yet, each of the judgments that flow from act utilitarianism conflicts with widespread, deeply held moral beliefs. Because act utilitarianism approves of actions that most people see as obviously morally wrong, we can know that it is a false moral theory.
ii. The “Undermining Trust” Objection
Although act utilitarians criticize traditional moral rules for being too rigid, critics charge that utilitarians ignore the fact that this alleged rigidity is the basis for trust between people. If, in cases like the ones described above, judges, doctors, and promise-makers are committed to doing whatever maximizes well-being, then no one will be able to trust that judges will act according to the law, that doctors will not use the organs of one patient to benefit others, and that promise-makers will keep their promises. More generally, if everyone believed that morality permitted lying, promise-breaking, cheating, and violating the law whenever doing so led to good results, then no one could trust other people to obey these rules. As a result, in an act utilitarian society, we could not believe what others say, could not rely on them to keep promises, and in general could not count on people to act in accord with important moral rules. As a result, people’s behavior would lack the kind of predictability and consistency that are required to sustain trust and social stability.
iii. Partiality and the “Too Demanding” Objection
Critics also attack utilitarianism’s commitment to impartiality and the equal consideration of interests. An implication of this commitment is that whenever people want to buy something for themselves or for a friend or family member, they must first determine whether they could create more well-being by donating their money to help unknown strangers who are seriously ill or impoverished. If more good can be done by helping strangers than by purchasing things for oneself or people one personally cares about, then act utilitarianism requires us to use the money to help strangers in need. Why? Because act utilitarianism requires impartiality and the equal consideration of all people’s needs and interests.
Almost everyone, however, believes that we have special moral duties to people who are near and dear to us. As a result, most people would reject the notion that morality requires us to treat people we love and care about no differently from people who are perfect strangers as absurd.
This issue is not merely a hypothetical case. In a famous article, Peter Singer defends the view that people living in affluent countries should not purchase luxury items for themselves when the world is full of impoverished people. According to Singer, a person should keep donating money to people in dire need until the donor reaches the point where giving to others generates more harm to the donor than the good that is generated for the recipients.
Critics claim that the argument for using our money to help impoverished strangers rather than benefiting ourselves and people we care about only proves one thing—that act utilitarianism is false. There are two reasons that show why it is false. First, it fails to recognize the moral legitimacy of giving special preferences to ourselves and people that we know and care about. Second, since pretty much everyone is strongly motivated to act on behalf of themselves and people they care about, a morality that forbids this and requires equal consideration of strangers is much too demanding. It asks more than can reasonably be expected of people.
c. Possible Responses to Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism
There are two ways in which act utilitarians can defend their view against these criticisms. First, they can argue that critics misinterpret act utilitarianism and mistakenly claim that it is committed to supporting the wrong answer to various moral questions. This reply agrees that the “wrong answers” are genuinely wrong, but it denies that the “wrong answers” maximize utility. Because they do not maximize utility, these wrong answers would not be supported by act utilitarians and therefore, do nothing to weaken their theory.
Second, act utilitarians can take a different approach by agreeing with the critics that act utilitarianism supports the views that critics label “wrong answers.” Act utilitarians may reply that all this shows is that the views supported by act utilitarianism conflict with common sense morality. Unless critics can prove that common sense moral beliefs are correct the criticisms have no force. Act utilitarians claim that their theory provides good reasons to reject many ordinary moral claims and to replace them with moral views that are based on the effects of actions.
People who are convinced by the criticisms of act utilitarianism may decide to reject utilitarianism entirely and adopt a different type of moral theory. This judgment, however, would be sound only if act utilitarianism were the only type of utilitarian theory. If there are other versions of utilitarianism that do not have act utilitarianism’s flaws, then one may accept the criticisms of act utilitarianism without forsaking utilitarianism entirely. This is what defenders of rule utilitarianism claim. They argue that rule utilitarianism retains the virtues of a utilitarian moral theory but without the flaws of the act utilitarian version.
4. Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
Unlike act utilitarians, who try to maximize overall utility by applying the utilitarian principle to individual acts, rule utilitarians believe that we can maximize utility only by setting up a moral code that contains rules. The correct moral rules are those whose inclusion in our moral code will produce better results (more well-being) than other possible rules. Once we determine what these rules are, we can then judge individual actions by seeing if they conform to these rules. The principle of utility, then, is used to evaluate rules and is not applied directly to individual actions. Once the rules are determined, compliance with these rules provides the standard for evaluating individual actions.
a. Arguments for Rule Utilitarianism
i. Why Rule Utilitarianism Maximizes Utility
Rule utilitarianism sounds paradoxical. It says that we can produce more beneficial results by following rules than by always performing individual actions whose results are as beneficial as possible. This suggests that we should not always perform individual actions that maximize utility. How could this be something that a utilitarian would support?
In spite of this paradox, rule utilitarianism possesses its own appeal, and its focus on moral rules can sound quite plausible. The rule utilitarian approach to morality can be illustrated by considering the rules of the road. If we are devising a code for drivers, we can adopt either open-ended rules like “drive safely” or specific rules like “stop at red lights,” “do not travel more than 30 miles per hour in residential areas,” “do not drive when drunk,” etc. The rule “drive safely”, like the act utilitarian principle, is a very general rule that leaves it up to individuals to determine what the best way to drive in each circumstance is. More specific rules that require stopping at lights, forbid going faster than 30 miles per hour, or prohibit driving while drunk do not give drivers the discretion to judge what is best to do. They simply tell drivers what to do or not do while driving.
The reason why a more rigid rule-based system leads to greater overall utility is that people are notoriously bad at judging what is the best thing to do when they are driving a car. Having specific rules maximizes utility by limiting drivers’ discretionary judgments and thereby decreasing the ways in which drivers may endanger themselves and others.
A rule utilitarian can illustrate this by considering the difference between stop signs and yield signs. Stop signs forbid drivers to go through an intersection without stopping, even if the driver sees that there are no cars approaching and thus no danger in not stopping. A yield sign permits drivers to go through without stopping unless they judge that approaching cars make it dangerous to drive through the intersection. The key difference between these signs is the amount of discretion that they give to the driver.
The stop sign is like the rule utilitarian approach. It tells drivers to stop and does not allow them to calculate whether it would be better to stop or not. The yield sign is like act utilitarianism. It permits drivers to decide whether there is a need to stop. Act utilitarians see the stop sign as too rigid because it requires drivers to stop even when nothing bad will be prevented. The result, they say, is a loss of utility each time a driver stops at a stop sign when there is no danger from oncoming cars.
Rule utilitarians will reply that they would reject the stop sign method a) if people could be counted on to drive carefully and b) if traffic accidents only caused limited amounts of harm. But, they say, neither of these is true. Because people often drive too fast and are inattentive while driving (because they are, for example, talking, texting, listening to music, or tired), we cannot count on people to make good utilitarian judgments about how to drive safely. In addition, the costs (i.e. the disutility) of accidents can be very high. Accident victims (including drivers) may be killed, injured, or disabled for life. For these reasons, rule utilitarians support the use of stop signs and other non-discretionary rules under some circumstances. Overall these rules generate greater utility because they prevent more disutility (from accidents) than they create (from “unnecessary” stops).
Rule utilitarians generalize from this type of case and claim that our knowledge of human behavior shows that there are many cases in which general rules or practices are more likely to promote good effects than simply telling people to do whatever they think is best in each individual case.
This does not mean that rule utilitarians always support rigid rules without exceptions. Some rules can identify types of situations in which the prohibition is over-ridden. In emergency medical situations, for example, a driver may justifiably go through a red light or stop sign based on the driver’s own assessment that a) this can be done safely and b) the situation is one in which even a short delay might cause dire harms. So the correct rule need not be “never go through a stop sign” but rather can be something like “never go through a stop sign except in cases that have properties a and b.” In addition, there will remain many things about driving or other behavior that can be left to people’s discretion. The rules of the road do not tell drivers when to drive or what their destination should be for example.
Overall then, rule utilitarian can allow departures from rules and will leave many choices up to individuals. In such cases, people may act in the manner that looks like the approach supported by act utilitarians. Nonetheless, these discretionary actions are permitted because having a rule in these cases does not maximize utility or because the best rule may impose some constraints on how people act while still permitting a lot of discretion in deciding what to do.
ii. Rule Utilitarianism Avoids the Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism
As discussed earlier, critics of act utilitarianism raise three strong objections against it. According to these critics, act utilitarianism a) approves of actions that are clearly wrong; b) undermines trust among people, and c) is too demanding because it requires people to make excessive levels of sacrifice. Rule utilitarians tend to agree with these criticisms of act utilitarianism and try to explain why rule utilitarianism is not open to any of these objections.
1. Judges, Doctors, and Promise-makers
Critics of act utilitarianism claim that it allows judges to sentence innocent people to severe punishments when doing so will maximize utility, allows doctors to kill healthy patients if by doing so, they can use the organs of one person to save more lives, and allows people to break promises if that will create slightly more benefits than keeping the promise.
Rule utilitarians say that they can avoid all these charges because they do not evaluate individual actions separately but instead support rules whose acceptance maximizes utility. To see the difference that their focus on rules makes, consider which rule would maximize utility: a) a rule that allows medical doctors to kill healthy patients so that they can use their organs for transplants that will save a larger number of patients who would die without these organs; or b) a rule that forbids doctors to remove the organs of healthy patients in order to benefit other patients.
Although more good may be done by killing the healthy patient in an individual case, it is unlikely that more overall good will be done by having a rule that allows this practice. If a rule were adopted that allows doctors to kill healthy patients when this will save more lives, the result would be that many people would not go to doctors at all. A rule utilitarian evaluation will take account of the fact that the benefits of medical treatment would be greatly diminished because people would no longer trust doctors. People who seek medical treatment must have a high degree of trust in doctors. If they had to worry that doctors might use their organs to help other patients, they would not, for example, allow doctors to anesthetize them for surgery because the resulting loss of consciousness would make them completely vulnerable and unable to defend themselves. Thus, the rule that allows doctors to kill one patient to save five would not maximize utility.
The same reasoning applies equally to the case of the judge. In order to have a criminal justice system that protects people from being harmed by others, we authorize judges and other officials to impose serious punishments on people who are convicted of crimes. The purpose of this is to provide overall security to people in their jurisdiction, but this requires that criminal justice officials only have the authority to impose arrest and imprisonment on people who are actually believed to be guilty. They do not have the authority to do whatever they think will lead to the best results in particular cases. Whatever they do must be constrained by rules that limit their power. Act utilitarians may sometimes support the intentional punishment of innocent people, but rule utilitarians will understand the risks involved and will oppose a practice that allows it.
Rule utilitarians offer a similar analysis of the promise keeping case. They explain that in general, we want people to keep their promises even in some cases in which doing so may lead to less utility than breaking the promise. The reason for this is that the practice of promise-keeping is a very valuable. It enables people to have a wide range of cooperative relationships by generating confidence that other people will do what they promise to do. If we knew that people would fail to keep promises whenever some option arises that leads to more utility, then we could not trust people who make promises to us to carry them through. We would always have to worry that some better option (one that act utilitarians would favor) might emerge, leading to the breaking of the person’s promise to us.
In each of these cases then, rule utilitarians can agree with the critics of act utilitarianism that it is wrong for doctors, judges, and promise-makers to do case by case evaluations of whether they should harm their patients, convict and punish innocent people, and break promises. The rule utilitarian approach stresses the value of general rules and practices, and shows why compliance with rules often maximizes overall utility even if in some individual cases, it requires doing what produces less utility.
2. Maintaining vs. Undermining Trust
Rule utilitarians see the social impact of a rule-based morality as one of the key virtues of their theory. The three cases just discussed show why act utilitarianism undermines trust but rule utilitarianism does not. Fundamentally, in the cases of doctors, judges, and promise-keepers, it is trust that is at stake. Being able to trust other people is extremely important to our well-being. Part of trusting people involves being able to predict what they will and won’t do. Because act utilitarians are committed to a case by case evaluation method, the adoption of their view would make people’s actions much less predictable. As a result, people would be less likely to see other people as reliable and trustworthy. Rule utilitarianism does not have this problem because it is committed to rules, and these rules generate positive “expectation effects” that give us a basis for knowing how other people are likely to behave.
While rule utilitarians do not deny that there are people who are not trustworthy, they can claim that their moral code generally condemns violations of trust as wrongful acts. The problem with act utilitarians is that they support a moral view that has the effect of undermining trust and that sacrifices the good effects of a moral code that supports and encourages trustworthiness.
3. Impartiality and the Problem of Over-Demandingness
Rule utilitarians believe that their view is also immune to the criticism that act utilitarianism is too demanding. In addition, while the act utilitarian commitment to impartiality undermines the moral relevance of personal relations, rule utilitarians claim that their view is not open to this criticism. They claim that rule utilitarianism allows for partiality toward ourselves and others with whom we share personal relationships. Moreover, they say, rule utilitarianism can recognize justifiable partiality to some people without rejecting the commitment to impartiality that is central to the utilitarian tradition.
How can rule utilitarianism do this? How can it be an impartial moral theory while also allowing partiality in people’s treatment of their friends, family, and others with whom they have a special connection?
In his defense of rule utilitarianism, Brad Hooker distinguishes two different contexts in which partiality and impartiality play a role. One involves the justification of moral rules and the other concerns the application of moral rules. Justifications of moral rules, he claims, must be strictly impartial. When we ask whether a rule should be adopted, it is essential to consider the impact of the rule on all people and to weigh the interests of everyone equally.
The second context concerns the content of the rules and how they are applied in actual cases. Rule utilitarians argue that a rule utilitarian moral code will allow partiality to play a role in determining what morality requires, forbids, or allows us to do. As an example, consider a moral rule parents have a special duty to care for their own children. (See Parental Rights and Obligations.) This is a partialist rule because it not only allows but actually requires parents to devote more time, energy, and other resources to their own children than to others. While it does not forbid devoting resources to other people’s children, it allows people to give to their own. While the content of this rule is not impartial, rule utilitarians believe it can be impartially justified. Partiality toward children can be justified for several reasons. Caring for children is a demanding activity. Children need the special attention of adults to develop physically, emotionally, and cognitively. Because children’s needs vary, knowledge of particular children’s needs is necessary to benefit them. For these reasons, it is plausible to believe that children’s well-being can best be promoted by a division of labor that requires particular parents (or other caretakers) to focus primarily on caring for specific children rather than trying to take care of all children. It is not possible for absentee parents or strangers to provide individual children with all that they need. Therefore, we can maximize the overall well-being of children as a class by designating certain people as the caretakers for specific children. For these reasons, partiality toward specific children can be impartially justified.
Similar “division of labor” arguments can be used to provide impartial justifications of other partialist rules and practices. Teachers, for example have special duties to students in their own classes and have no duty to educate all students. Similarly, public officials can and should be partial to people in the jurisdiction in which they work. If the overall aim is to maximize the well-being of all people in all cities, for example, then we are likely to get better results by having individuals who know and understand particular cities focus on them while other people focus on other cities.
Based on examples like these, rule utilitarians claim that their view, unlike act utilitarianism, avoids the problems raised about demandingness and partiality. Being committed to impartialist justifications of moral rules does not commit them to rejecting moral rules that allow or require people to give specific others priority.
While rule utilitarians can defend partiality, their commitment to maximizing overall utility also allows them to justify limits on the degree of partiality that is morally permissible. At a minimum, rule utilitarians will support a rule that forbids parents to harm other people’s children in order to advance the interests of their own children. (It would be wrong, for example, for a parent to injure children who are running in a school race in order to increase the chances that their own children will win.) Moreover, though this is more controversial, rule utilitarians may support a rule that says that if parents are financially well-off and if their own children’s needs are fully met, these parents may have a moral duty to contribute some resources for children who are deprived of essential resources.
The key point is that while rule utilitarianism permits partiality toward some people, it can also generate rules that limit the ways in which people may act partially and it might even support a positive duty for well off people to provide assistance to strangers when the needs and interests of people to whom we are partial are fully met, when they have surplus resources that could be used to assist strangers in dire conditions, and when there are ways to channel these resources effectively to people in dire need.
b. Arguments against Rule Utilitarianism
i. The “Rule Worship” Objection
Act utilitarians criticize rule utilitarians for irrationally supporting rule-based actions in cases where more good could be done by violating the rule than obeying it. They see this as a form of “rule worship,” an irrational deference to rules that has no utilitarian justification (J. J. C. Smart).
Act utilitarians say that they recognize that rules can have value. For example, rules can provide a basis for acting when there is no time to deliberate. In addition, rules can define a default position, a justification for doing (or refraining from) a type of action as long as there is no reason for not doing it. But when people know that more good can be done by violating the rule then the default position should be over-ridden.
ii. The “Collapses into Act Utilitarianism” Objection
While the “rule worship” objection assumes that rule utilitarianism is different from act utilitarianism, some critics deny that this is the case. In their view, whatever defects act utilitarianism may have, rule utilitarianism will have the same defects. According to this criticism, although rule utilitarianism looks different from act utilitarianism, a careful examination shows that it collapses into or, as David Lyons claimed, is extensionally equivalent to act utilitarianism.
To understand this criticism, it is worth focusing on a distinction between rule utilitarianism and other non-utilitarian theories. Consider Kant’s claim that lying is always morally wrong, even when lying would save a person’s life. Many people see this view as too rigid and claim that it fails to take into account the circumstances in which a lie is being told. A more plausible rule would say “do not lie except in special circumstances that justify lying.” But what are these special circumstances? For a utilitarian, it is natural to say that the correct rule is “do not lie except when lying will generate more good than telling the truth.”
Suppose that a rule utilitarian adopts this approach and advocates a moral code that consists of a list of rules of this form. The rules would say something like “do x except when not doing x maximizes utility” and “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” While this may sound plausible, it is easy to see that this version of rule utilitarianism is in fact identical with act utilitarianism. Whatever action x is, the moral requirement and the moral prohibition expressed in these rules collapses into the act utilitarian rules “do x only when not doing x maximizes utility” or “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” These rules say exactly the same thing as the open-ended act utilitarian rule “Do whatever action maximizes utility.”
If rule utilitarianism is to be distinct from act utilitarianism, its supporters must find a way to formulate rules that allow exceptions to a general requirement or prohibition while not collapsing into act utilitarianism. One way to do this is to identify specific conditions under which violating a general moral requirement would be justified. Instead of saying that we can violate a general rule whenever doing so will maximize utility, the rule utilitarian code might say things like “Do not lie except to prevent severe harms to people who are not unjustifiably threatening others with severe harm.” This type of rule would prohibit lying generally, but it would permit lying to a murderer to prevent harm to the intended victims even if the lie would lead to harm to the murderer. In cases of lesser harms or deceitful acts that will benefit the liar, lying would still be prohibited, even if lying might maximize overall utility.
Rule utilitarians claim that this sort of rule is not open to the “collapses into act utilitarianism” objection. It also suggests, however, that rule utilitarians face difficult challenges in formulating utility-based rules that have a reasonable degree of flexibility built into them but are not so flexible that they collapse into act utilitarianism. In addition, although the rules that make up a moral code should be flexible enough to account for the complexities of life, they cannot be so complex that they are too difficult for people to learn and understand.
iii. Wrong Answers and Crude Concepts
Although rule utilitarians try to avoid the weaknesses attributed to act utilitarianism, critics argue that they cannot avoid these weaknesses because they do not take seriously many of our central moral concepts. As a result, they cannot support the right answers to crucial moral problems. Three prominent concepts in moral thought that critics cite are justice, rights, and desert. These moral ideas are often invoked in reasoning about morality, but critics claim that neither rule nor act utilitarianism acknowledge their importance. Instead, they focus only on the amounts of utility that actions or rules generate.
In considering the case, for example, of punishing innocent people, the best that rule utilitarians can do is to say that a rule that permits this would lead to worse results overall than a rule that permitted it. This prediction, however, is precarious. While it may be true, it may also be false, and if it is false, then utilitarians must acknowledge that intentionally punishing an innocent person could sometimes be morally justified.
Against this, critics may appeal to common sense morality to support the view that there are no circumstances in which punishing the innocent can be justified because the innocent person is a) being treated unjustly, b) has a right not to be punished for something that he or she is not guilty of, and c) does not deserve to be punished for a crime that he or she did not commit.
In responding, rule utilitarians may begin, first, with the view that they do not reject concepts like justice, rights, and desert. Instead, they accept and use these concepts but interpret them from the perspective of maximizing utility. To speak of justice, rights, and desert is to speak of rules of individual treatment that are very important, and what makes them important is their contribution to promoting overall well-being. Moreover, even people who accept these concepts as basic still need to determine whether it is always wrong to treat someone unjustly, violate their rights, or treat them in ways that they don’t deserve.
Critics object to utilitarianism by claiming that the theory justifies treating people unjustly, violating their rights, etc. This criticism only stands up if it is always wrong and thus never morally justified to treat people in these ways. Utilitarians argue that moral common sense is less absolutist than their critics acknowledge. In the case of punishment, for example, while we hope that our system of criminal justice gives people fair trials and conscientiously attempts to separate the innocent from the guilty, we know that the system is not perfect. As a result, people who are innocent are sometimes prosecuted, convicted, and punished for crimes they did not do.
This is the problem of wrongful convictions, which poses a difficult challenge to critics of utilitarianism. If we know that our system of criminal justice punishes some people unjustly and in ways they don’t deserve, we are faced with a dilemma. Either we can shut down the system and punish no one, or we can maintain the system even though we know that it will result in some innocent people being unjustly punished in ways that they do not deserve. Most people will support continuing to punish people in spite of the fact that it involves punishing some people unjustly. According to rule utilitarians, this can only be justified if a rule that permits punishments (after a fair trial, etc.) yields more overall utility than a rule that rejects punishment because it treats some people unfairly. To end the practice of punishment entirely—because it inevitably causes some injustice—is likely to result in worse consequences because it deprives society of a central means of protecting people’s well-being, including what are regarded as their rights. In the end, utilitarians say, it is justice and rights that give way when rules that approve of violations in some cases yield the greatest amount of utility.
5. Conclusion
The debate between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism highlights many important issues about how we should make moral judgments. Act utilitarianism stresses the specific context and the many individual features of the situations that pose moral problems, and it presents a single method for dealing with these individual cases. Rule utilitarianism stresses the recurrent features of human life and the ways in which similar needs and problems arise over and over again. From this perspective, we need rules that deal with types or classes of actions: killing, stealing, lying, cheating, taking care of our friends or family, punishing people for crimes, aiding people in need, etc. Both of these perspectives, however, agree that the main determinant of what is right or wrong is the relationship between what we do or what form our moral code takes and what is the impact of our moral perspective on the level of people’s well-being.
6. References and Further Reading
a. Classic Works
- Jeremy Bentham. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, available in many editions, 1789.
- See Book I, chapter 1 for Bentham’s statement of what utilitarianism is; chapter IV for his method of measuring amounts of pleasure/utility; chapter V for his list of types of pleasures and pains, and chapter XIII for his application of utilitarianism to questions about criminal punishment.
- John Stuart Mill. Utilitarianism, available in many editions and online, 1861.
- See especially chapter II, in which Mill tries both to clarify and defend utilitarianism. Passages at the end of chapter suggest that Mill was a rule utilitarian. In chapter V, Mill tries to show that utilitarianism is compatible with justice.
- Henry Sidgwick. The Methods of Ethics, Seventh Edition, available in many editions, 1907.
- Sidgwick is known for his careful, extended analysis of utilitarian moral theory and competing views.
- G. E. Moore. Principia Ethica, 1903.
- Moore criticizes aspects of Mill’s views but support a non-hedonistic form of utilitarianism.
- G. E. Moore. Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1912.
- Mostly focused on utilitarianism, this book contains a combination of act and rule utilitarian ideas.
b. More Recent Utilitarians
- J. J. C. Smart. “An Outline of a System of Utilitarian Ethics” in J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Smart’s discussion combines an overview of moral theory and a defense of act utilitarianism. It is followed by Bernard Williams’, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” a source of many important criticisms of utilitarianism.
- Richard Brandt. Ethical Theory. Prentice Hall, 1959. Chapter 15.
- Brandt, who coined the terms “act” and “rule” utilitarianism, explains and criticizes act utilitarianism and tentatively proposes a version of rule utilitarianism.
- Richard Brandt. Morality, Utilitarianism, and Rights. Cambridge University Press, 1992.
- Brandt developed and defended rule utilitarianism in many papers. This book contains several of them as well as works in which he applies rule utilitarian thinking to issues like rights and the ethics of war.
- R. M. Hare. Moral Thinking. Oxford University Press, 1981.
- An interesting development of a form of rule utilitarianism by an influential moral theorist.
- John C. Harsanyi. “Morality and the Theory of Rational Behavior.” in Social Research 44.4 (1977): 623-656. (Reprinted in Amartya Sen and Bernard Williams, eds., Utilitarianism and Beyond, Cambridge University Press, 1982).
- Harsanyi, a Nobel Prize economist, defends rule utilitarianism, connecting it to a preference theory of value and a theory of rational action.
- John Rawls. “Two Concepts of Rules.” In Philosophical Review LXIV (1955), 3-32.
- Before becoming an influential critic of utilitarianism, Rawls wrote this defense of rule utilitarianism.
- Brad Hooker. Ideal Code, Real World: A Rule-consequentialist Theory of Morality. Oxford University Press, 2000.
- In this 21st century defense of rule utilitarianism, Hooker places it in the context of more recent developments in philosophy.
- Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. HarperCollins, 2000.
- Singer, a prolific, widely read thinker, mostly applies a utilitarian perspective to controversial moral issues (for example, euthanasia, the treatment of non-human animals, and global poverty) rather than discussing utilitarian moral theory. This volume contains selections from his books and articles.
- Peter Singer. “Famine, Affluence, and Morality” in Philosophy and Public Affairs 1 (1972), 229-43. Reprinted in Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. Harper Collins, 2000.
- This widely reprinted article, though it does not focus on utilitarianism, uses utilitarian reasoning and has sparked decades of debate about moral demandingness and moral impartiality.
- Robert Goodin. Utilitarianism as a Public Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- In a series of essays, Goodin argues that utilitarianism is the best philosophy for public decision-making even if it fails as an ethic for personal aspects of life.
- Derek Parfit. On What Matters. Oxford University Press, 1991.
- In a long, complex work, Parfit stresses the importance of Henry Sidgwick as a moral philosopher and argues that rule utilitarianism and Kantian deontology can be understood in a way that makes them compatible with one another.
c. Overviews
- Tim Mulgan. Understanding Utilitarianism. Acumen, 2007.
- This is a very clear description of utilitarianism, including explanations of arguments both for and against. Chapter 2 discusses Bentham, Mill, and Sidgwick while chapter 6 focuses on act and rule utilitarianism.
- Julia Driver, “The History of Utilitarianism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This article gives a good historical account of important figures in the development of utilitarianism.
- Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, “Consequentialism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This very useful overview is relevant to utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
- William Shaw. Contemporary Ethics: Taking Account of Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 1999.
- Shaw provides a clear, comprehensive discussion of utilitarianism and its critics as well as defending utilitarianism.
- John Troyer. The Classical Utilitarians: Bentham and Mill. Hackett, 2003.
- Troyer’s introduction to this book of selections from Mill and Bentham is clear and informative.
- Ben Eggleston and Dale Miller, eds. The Cambridge Companion to Utilitarianism. Cambridge University Press, 2014.
- This collection contains sixteen essays on utilitarianism, including essays on historical figures as well as discussion of 21st century issues, including both act and rule utilitarianism.
d. J. S. Mill and Utilitarian Moral Theory
- J. O. Urmson. “The Interpretation of the Moral Philosophy of J. S. Mill,” in Philosophical Quarterly (1953) 3, 33-9.
- This article generated renewed interest in both Mill’s moral theory and rule utilitarianism.
- Roger Crisp. Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Mill on Utilitarianism. Routledge, 1997.
- A clear discussion of Mill’s Utilitarianism with chapters on key topics as well as on Mill’s On Liberty and The Subjection of Women.
- Henry. R. West, ed. The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 2006.
- This contains the complete text of Mill’s Utilitarianism preceded by three essays on the background to Mill’s utilitarianism and followed by five interpretative essays and four focusing on contemporary issues.
- Henry R. West. An Introduction to Mill’s Utilitarian Ethics. Cambridge University Press, 2004.
- A clear discussion of Mill; Chapter 4 argues that Mill is neither an act nor a rule utilitarian. Chapter 6 focuses on utilitarianism and justice.
- Dale Miller. J. S. Mill. Polity Press, 2010.
- Miller, in Chapter 6, argues that Mill was a rule utilitarian.
- Stephen Nathanson. “John Stuart Mill on Economic Justice and the Alleviation of Poverty,” in Journal of Social Philosophy, XLIII, no. 2.
- Drawing on Mill’s Principles of Political Economy, Nathanson claims that Mill was a rule utilitarian and provides an interpretation of Mill’s views on economic justice.
- Wendy Donner, “Mill’s Utilitarianism” in John Skorupski, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Mill. Cambridge University Press, 1998, 255–92.
- A discussion of Mill’s views and some recent interpretations of them.
- David Lyons. Rights, Welfare, and Mill’s Moral Theory. Oxford, 1994.
- In this series of papers, Lyons defends Mill’s view of morality against some critics, differentiates Mill’s views from both act and rule utilitarianism, and criticizes Mill’s attempt to show that utilitarianism can account for justice.
e. Critics of Utilitarianism
- David Lyons. Forms and Limits of Utilitarianism. Oxford, 1965.
- Lyons argues that at least some versions of rule utilitarianism collapse into act utilitarianism.
- David Lyons. “The Moral Opacity of Utilitarianism” in Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- In a challenging essay, Lyons raises doubts about whether there is any coherent version of utilitarianism.
- Judith Jarvis Thomson. “The Trolley Problem.” Yale Law Journal 94 (1985), 1395-1415. Reprinted in Judith Jarvis Thomson. Rights, Restitution and Risk. Edited by William Parent. Harvard University Press, 1986; Chapter 7.
- An influential rights-based discussion in which Jarvis Thomson uses hypothetical cases to show, among other things, that utilitarianism cannot explain why some actions that cause killings are permissible and others not.
- Bernard Williams, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” In J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Williams’ contribution to this debate contains arguments and examples that have played an important role in debates about utilitarianism and moral theory.
f. Collections of Essays
- Michael D. Bayles, ed. Contemporary Utilitarianism. Garden City: Doubleday, 1968.
- Ten essays that debate act vs. rule utilitarianism as well as whether a form of utilitarianism is correct.
- Samuel Gorovitz, ed. John Stuart Mill: Utilitarianism, With Critical Essays. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company, 1971.
- This includes Mill’s Utlitarianism plus a rich array of twenty-eight (pre-1970) articles interpreting, defending, and criticizing utilitarianism.
- Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- Thirteen essays on utilitarianism, many focused on issues concerning rule utilitarianism.
- Samuel Scheffler. Consequentialism and Its Critics. Oxford, 1988.
- This contains a dozen influential articles, mostly by prominent critics of utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
- Amartya Sen, and Bernard Williams, eds. Utilitarianism and Beyond. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
- This contains fourteen articles, including essays defending utilitarianism by R. M. Hare and John Harsanyi, As the title suggests, however, most of the articles are critical of utilitarianism.
Author Information
Stephen Nathanson
Email: s.nathanson@neu.edu
Northeastern University
U. S. A.