Postmodernism

Postmodernism is a style of doing philosophy that is often distinguished from the analytic style. The Postmodern era is the time period when postmodernism was popular, especially in Europe.
Many scholars struggle to provide a definition that characterizes postmodernism. The fact that it lacks a unique identifying name but is called “post”—meaning that it comes after modernism—is a sign of this uncertainty. Ihab Hassan offers a useful list of characteristics applied to the postmodern from various theoretical and artistic fields. These include claims that it is playful, rhetorical, indeterminate, anarchic, performative, participatory, polymorphous, antithetical, dispersed, and anti-narrative, to name some of the most prevalent throughout the literature. He implies that each of these can be broken down further. Indeterminacy, for example, evokes ambiguity, discontinuity, heterodoxy, pluralism, randomness, revolt, perversion, and deformation. Although it is possible to list the names of likely postmodern thinkers, actors, and their productions from philosophy, culture, and the arts, there is considerable disagreement about who or what belongs to this category and who remains modern. The long list of concepts and the uncertainty about which thinkers should retain the title of modern makes it useful to begin with a brief account of the Modern era in order to indicate which aspects of it might have continued to shape and influence its aftermath—the Postmodern.

Defining Modernity
Postmodern Cultural Transformation
Lyotard and The Conditions of the Postmodern
The Delegitimation and Legitimation of Knowledge
The Limits of Postmodern Communication
Rorty and The Broken Mirror
Baudrillard’s Logic of Simulation
The Great Trauma of Postmodern Thought, Deterrence, and the Implosion of Meaning
Seizing Reality and Embracing Nihilism
The Arts and The Ruin of Representation
The Architecture of Multivalence
The End of Postmodernism in Astral America
References and Further Reading

1. Defining Modernity

Taken in its most specific sense, the roots of modernity were already visible in the 18^th century. The Modern era arose in the mid to late 19^th century and continued through the mid-20^th century. The Marxist scholar David Harvey (1990) cites the philosopher Jürgen Habermas (1983), who defines modernity as the intellectual and cultural project that produced objectivity in science, the domination of nature, universal morality and law, and autonomy in the arts and culture (TCP 12, MIP 9). It was commonly assumed that the norms of scientific objectivity and factual truth were the tools that make possible the refutation of myth, superstition, religion, and heredity systems of privilege such as a ruling aristocracy. Carrying this out required increased rationality in multiple areas of society.

Like the postmodern to follow, the modern or modernity “entails a ruthless break with any or all preceding historical conditions”, and so it is “characterized by a never-ending process of internal ruptures and fragmentations within itself” (TCP 12). This condition may appear to contradict the rationality of modernity, but it makes sense for an era that reached a low point with the onset of World War II and the Holocaust. The destruction of values and customs is not a peaceful process and many of the luminaries of the Modern era were among its most active destroyers. Among them we find Georges-Eugène Haussmann (1809-1891) ripping up medieval Paris to create boulevards; Frank Lloyd Wright (1867-1959) tearing down the boundaries between domesticity and nature; Pablo Picasso (1881-1973) destroying the image to create cubism; Ezra Pound (1885-1972) remaking poetry with precise and clear language while seduced by fascism; Robert Moses (1888-1981) bulldozing neighborhoods to build parks and highways; and the positivist philosophers who fled the Nazi’s for the United States, while declaring their philosophy to be the only true one (TCP 18-19).

These actions have been justified as important preliminaries to the promotion and creation of something stronger; namely, significant rational and functional cultural forms that introduce more and better order than what had existed prior to these efforts (CCC 52). The image of the machine and technology provided an easy and comprehensible symbol for many modernists. Nation-states and cities were envisioned as machines for living and the expression of universal values that would guard against encroachment from nationalistic politics and reactionary forces. Nevertheless, these values did not stop others from making use of the technology and bureaucracy of modernism to support socialist, fascist, and communist revolutions (TCP 33). The defeat of Nazism and fascism in World War II established a period referred to as High Modernism, which envisioned linear progress, absolute truths, and rational planning as the means to an ideal social order bringing human emancipation and economic benefits to war-torn countries. Modernist values were presumed universal, relevant not only to first-world developed countries but also exportable to what was then called the “backward Third World” under the control of Western nations (TCP 35).

The modernist drive for efficiency served the growing corporate bureaucratic power by abandoning ornamentation and personalization, especially for homes and public buildings. Often massive geometrical structures prevailed in public spaces. This uniformity spread into the arts and literature as universities established the Western canon in those fields. This ideal of classic literature, philosophy, and visual and performing arts became the model for Western culture. In the visual arts, abstraction became dominant as it avoided the representation of the horrors of war including the human and cultural destruction caused by the atom bomb (TCP 36). In the 1940s and 50s, abstract expressionism was practiced by artists like Mark Rothko, Jackson Pollock, Helen Frankenthaler, and Willem de Kooning. These artists, along with many others in the United States and Europe, sought to express the alienation, anxiety, and violence of the war, even as they celebrated “rugged individualism and creative expression” (TCP 37). These values were popularly taken up and became the basis of a drive toward universalization promoting America as “the essence of Western culture” and as the site of the celebration of freedom of expression (TCP 37). Thus, expressionist arts arose as part of the cultural protest against the dominant political authorities advocating policies that advanced corporate power and consumer culture in the United States and elsewhere.

This largely first-world interpretation of modern life also gave rise to anti-modernist movements opposed to technocratic rationality and institutionalized power (CCC 38). The sociologist Daniel Bell (1976) blames modernism for making the postmodern rebellion possible. He maintains that the spread of modernist art into the social and political mainstream was bolstered by the idea that it celebrates “the free creative spirit at war” (CCC 40). This is the idea of a cultural hero who is an individual at war with a civilization that curtails their freedom. Bell argues that this sustained a culture of rebellion that came to exert an outsized influence given its relatively small numbers. He argues that this prevented most everyday citizens from making what Bell calls an intellectually respectable culture of their own (CCC 41). Modernism is Bell’s most inclusive term for a “self-willed effort of a style and sensibility” that sought to remain in the forefront of the rest of society, the so-called avant-garde (CCC 46). It was exacerbated when what he refers to as radical intellectuals—mostly in the arts and letters—were invited to contribute to mass media magazines and newspapers. The reality, Bell maintains, is that mass society generally seeks entertainment and not elitist culture. In his view, radical elements dominated culture by embracing the mass media and using it as a lifeline to proclaim their cultural superiority (CCC 45).

If Bell is correct, then it would have been mass media celebrity that gave rise to postmodernism as an extension of the most extreme aspect of modernism, in part governed by impulse and pleasure. For Bell, postmodernism is dedicated to tearing down boundaries without replacing them with stable forms linked to social and political hierarchies and an idealized pre-modern past (CCC 50, 51). Whether or not this holds up to scrutiny, it has been argued that modernist ideas and productions being integrated into mainstream consumer culture on any scale implies that modernism no longer serves as a “revolutionary antidote” to traditional cultural practices (TCP 37).

2. Postmodern Cultural Transformation

Andreas Huyssen (1984), who regards the postmodern as “a slowly emerging cultural transformation in Western societies” (TCP 39), reconciles these opposing viewpoints to an extent. According to Huyssen, something may appear on one level as the latest fad, advertising pitch, or hollow spectacle, when in fact it belongs to the change in sensibility and cultural transformation that occurs regularly in Western societies (MP 8). Thus, the movement from era to era does not invoke a wholesale cultural, social, and economic paradigm shift (TCP 39). Instead, the postmodern must be addressed as a historical condition and not merely a style. It benefits from examining and analyzing its critical and artistic practices, but cannot be neatly defined. The point, Huyssen states, is not to ridicule the postmodern but to salvage it from both champions and detractors (MP 8, 9, 10). This calls for an increased emphasis on the outsize role the arts play in achieving this shift because the activities of artists, writers, filmmakers, architects, and performers have propelled culture beyond the narrow vision of modernism. In its place, they demanded a new version of modernism (MP 9)—a demand that leads to the postmodern.

Huyssen seeks to clarify the confusion surrounding the meaning of postmodernism by distinguishing two versions of it. One arose in the 1960s and sought to create a rebellious American upheaval of modernist European avant-garde movements such as surrealism. Its methods were both apocalyptic and visionary, sometimes an extension of modernism and sometimes an attempt at disruption. Americanization was one of the chief characteristics of this iteration of postmodernism, attacking European bourgeois institutions of modernist art and culture that separated them from everyday life. It embraced media, film, and photographic technology and validated popular culture, especially rock ‘n roll and folk music, as well as popular literature. Its goal, Huyssen states, was to undermine elitism (MP 20-3).

The second version of postmodernism emerged in the 1970s and turned its criticisms to the remaining modernist values of the 1960s in favor of a “culture of eclecticism” (MP 16). It incorporated motifs and codes from pre-modern and non-modern cultures, as well as those of popular mass culture, which it recognized in all its diversity (MP 25, 27). Additionally, the intellectual and cultural contributions of women and global minorities emerged as a challenge to essentialism and the Western canon and its traditions. Recent reassessments of the postmodern condition have drawn attention to the rise of gender, race, sexuality, and postcolonial studies widely associated with postmodern culture wars that may still serve as a lightning rod for polemics in the face of global pandemics, ecological catastrophe, and technological encroachment.

The increasing pluralism of voices and perspectives creates a plurality of interpretations, which for some amounted to a loss of meaning and the dissolution of any unified representation of reality. This diversity, widespread in the literature, nevertheless got its start in the project of modernity characterized by those who, like Habermas, retained faith in the modernist project and expressed the hope that these values would create and maintain the rational organization of everyday life. However, given the increasing distance between the culture of experts and specialists and that of the public in general, the modernist hold on the values of the Enlightenment appeared incomplete. The project to integrate objective science, morality, and art into everyday life remained unfulfilled. Nonetheless, although postmodernism seems contrary to the general values of the Enlightenment, aspects of the modernist project may still be present in theories of postmodernism. Many theorists do not view the efforts of postmodernism’s advocates and practitioners as eclectic and fragmentary. Instead, they describe the postmodern as a necessary discontinuity that contains elements of modernist liberatory values. If so, a full appreciation of the postmodern must address its perspective as eclectic and fragmentary as well as its liberatory aspect. The leading philosopher of postmodernism Jean-Francois Lyotard (1924-1998) perhaps best articulates the theoretical framework of this view.

3. Lyotard and The Conditions of the Postmodern

At the end of The Postmodern Condition, A Report on Knowledge (1984 [1979]), Jean-Francois Lyotard declares, “The nineteenth and twentieth centuries have given us as much terror as we can take” (PMC 81-82). He objects to the social, cultural, political, and economic rationalization of society by highly bureaucratic governments and business entities that seek efficiency, uniformity, and control, asserting this new version of terror is a threat to the proliferation of new and diverse ways of life. Uniformity and diversity are among the oppositions that characterize Lyotard’s understanding of the modern and its distinction from the postmodern in the realms of philosophy, science, history, aesthetics, and culture. The implication is that the modern and postmodern do not exist merely in the philosophical or the theoretical realms but embrace all aspects of society and culture. They correspond to the epistemes, the acts, ideas, and new methodologies giving rise to knowledge in an era, as articulated by Michel Foucault in The Order of Things (1970, [1966]). From this perspective, the Modern era is a foreclosure of one recent episteme, that of modernism. Its closure is due to the reorganization of knowledge in the modern humanist tradition—its influence, development, evolution, source, and origin—followed by its replacement by the postmodern episteme of discontinuity, rupture, threshold, limit, and transformation.

Lyotard uses the word “postmodern” (a word he claims was already in use among sociologists and critics in America) to describe the condition of knowledge in the most highly developed societies. It has become a truism that the postmodern reflects skepticism about metanarratives, that is, theories that claim to be comprehensive or universal throughout the institutions of science, literature, and the arts, as well as philosophy. This definition does not yet clarify the use and practice of the term postmodern. For Lyotard, a discussion of the rise of the postmodern as an aspect of computerized societies is missing. The focus of science and technology on computers and their languages, the impact of computational technical transformations on research, and the transmission of acquired learning that values quantities of information are, for him, fundamental to the postmodern. Lyotard argues that society moved from the training of minds to the exteriorization of knowledge in the machine, knowledge available for sale and consumption acting as the principal driver in the worldwide competition for power. Learning circulates like money once did, and value becomes a matter of units of knowledge exchanged for decision-making as opposed to being dedicated to the optimization of performance in work for the sake of paying for life’s ordinary expenses.

Computerization and science do not exist in a vacuum. Lyotard links them to politics and ethics, to the question of who decides what knowledge is, and who knows what needs to be decided. The experts with access to computer-generated data do not simply receive information. In their analyses, every “self” exists in a network of relations as sender, referent, and receiver, and the messages received are performative, denotative, evaluative, or descriptive. All are situated within the structures and uses prescribed by Ludwig Wittgenstein’s (1929-1951) language games, a method used to make sense of any episteme, not merely the postmodern. The philosopher Max Black (1979) describes language games as following one of three models: primitive, that is, simple patterns of language use such as those of a group of workers; sophisticated, such as language use requiring a background like that needed by translators; or finally, the general use of words that can degenerate into cliché (WLG 338-9).

Specifically, for the postmodern language game, there is “[a] cybernetic machine [that] does indeed run on information, but the goals programmed into it, for example, originate in prescriptive and evaluative statements it has no way to correct in the course of its functioning” (PMC 16). This procedure has removed Western societies from the narrative of traditional knowledge, such as that proposed by enlightenment rationality. Traditional narratives, Lyotard argues, have a three-fold competence: know-how, knowing how to speak, and knowing how to hear. These competencies transmit the pragmatic and useful rules of the social language into a fixed eternal form whose meaning is often obscure, yet they generally receive no independent verification. For Lyotard, the language game of the classic pragmatics of Western science is quite sophisticated and already produces judgments. It questions the validity of simple narrative statements and characterizes them as primitive (without objective knowledge) or opinion.

On the other hand, classic science uses only one language game, involving the production of verifiable or falsifiable statements about its referent. The verifiability or falsifiability of its statements contributes to its evolution as those statements follow strict rules that define proper scientific practices and make up its language game (PMC 25). Complementary to the “research game” is the “teaching game”—students who become experts, or competent equals. Separately, institutions form according to their own language games. People who work in civil institutions deliberate and formulate prescriptive utterances for justice, legislation, and civil laws. They are abstract subjects, that is, individuals who exclusively send and receive statements to be verified as either true or false. The effect is to destroy the traditional knowledge of peoples and communities not part of those institutions, and in principle, to reintroduce new narratives of knowledge, liberty, or freedom by creating new epistemes.

Still, the language games of science and those of ethical, social, and political practice conflict. Unification of these diverse language games would require a meta-narrative whose narrator must therefore be a meta-subject. This would be someone able to formulate and validate the legitimacy of the discourses of the empirical sciences and the institutions of popular cultures (PMC 34). Lyotard situates the initial unification process in the universities. First in the 18^th century universities of Berlin, then in the 19^th and 20^th centuries, spreading to the United States and other mostly Western nations. Institutional research and the spread of learning do not serve the state. For these universities, knowledge is entitled to define what constitutes the state and society (PMC 34). This is not knowledge of specifics such as nature, the state, or society, but knowledge of that knowledge; indirect knowledge, composed of reported statements incorporated into the metanarrative, the comprehensive account of a subject who vouches for the legitimacy of the method used to study nature, the state, or society.

Likewise, the practical subject—humanity—is animated by the self-management of its freedom and does not look to nature or natural law. Humanity’s laws are assumed to be just, because the very citizens subject to them also constitute them. This language game turns morality into an effect of knowledge, including science, by claiming that knowledge exists only to serve the practical ethical subject. Of course, as Lyotard points out, scientists will cooperate only if they agree that the prescriptions of humanity are just. Richard Rorty (1983) reiterates this view, arguing that for postmodernism there is no ground for loyalty and conviction apart from the fact that the beliefs, desires, and emotions of the members of various groups overlap with those of many others with whom they identify for purposes of moral or political discussion. These beliefs, desires, and emotions must be distinctive group features accumulated over time and used by the group to construct its self-image in contrast to other groups. The group narrative is not likely to be philosophical. Generally, it is an historical narrative largely legitimized by appealing to a multitude of artistic practices about the past and predictions about the future derived from history and the arts.

4. The Delegitimation and Legitimation of Knowledge

For Lyotard, these specific language games and how the meta-narrative legitimizes knowledge declined with the rise of technologies developed since World War II that emphasize technological advances, that is, means rather than ends. Post-World War II technologies also tended to promote the benefits of the individual enjoyment of goods and services under advanced liberal capitalism. Lyotard states that skepticism toward knowledge is already implicit in G.W. Hegel’s (1770-1831) speculative philosophy. In Hegel’s analysis, discourse referring to nature in all its breadth and depth must be sublated, that is, raised or transformed into another discourse without negating the previous ones. The original discourse about natural science, for example, can be cited in a second-level discourse, meaning it is not self-legitimating, and therefore not a true science but an ideology or instrument of power. This erodes the principle of legitimizing knowledge and dissolves the hierarchy of disciplines into flat networks of areas of inquiry dominated by institutes and foundations. From this point of view, universities are no longer at the forefront of research, they merely transmit knowledge “didactically replicating teachers rather than producing researchers” (PMC 39). The appeal to ethical, social, and political practices to justify discourses further corrodes the truth value of the search for knowledge in favor of the question of its relevance, which is exacerbated by the claim that science, as a language game with its own rules, has no privilege concerning other practices. Given this situation, for Lyotard, postmodernism arises to make sense of if and where legitimation can be found.

For scientific research, legitimation has come to be situated in the syntax of formal deterministic systems which demand completeness, decidability, and independent axioms governed by the metalanguages of logic and mathematics. However, Kurt Gödel’s (1906-1978) incompleteness theorem exposes the limits of formal systems and the existence of paradoxes and paralogisms due to the limits of consistency and completeness. Gödel himself eventually offered the anti-mechanistic statement that “either . . . the human mind (even within the realm of pure mathematics) infinitely surpasses the power of any finite machine, or else there exist unsolvable diophantine problems” where the word diophantine refers to solving all the unknowns in the problem (1951). Yet if the referent of science is reality, then scientific claims still seem to call for a standard of proof independent of inconsistent and unreliable sensory perceptions. If logic and mathematics cannot provide completeness, then technology will. Technology, however, operates on the principle of optimal performance, maximizing output and minimizing input. Its game is not truth, but efficiency. Insofar as technology is marketed, science must meet the demands of performance and the commercialization that produces wealth.

With completeness and legitimation eroded, Lyotard taps performativity—the power of language to effect action—as the only viable standard of proof. Insofar as performativity exists for the sake of power (understood as making the best move in the technical language game) rather than terror (eliminating other players), the performativity of procedures can substitute for the normativity previously provided by laws. As Lyotard famously writes, “[p]ower is not only good performativity but also effective verification and good verdicts” (PMC 47). This becomes the method by which the new logic of power legitimates science and law.

Educational institutions do not escape the new logic. In Lyotard’s analysis, they create skills with the guidance of experts in technology, mathematics, logic, and related fields. Thus, professional and technical training begins to dominate educational institutions, leaving behind students in the arts and human sciences for whom jobs are scarce. Job retraining and continuing education are offered randomly to facilitate employment and promotion to those left behind. Insofar as knowledge has become translatable into computer languages, the role of teachers is greatly diminished. Effectively, Lyotard claims, the teaching function is easily replaced by the data banks of machine learning, as the professor is held to be no more competent than these data banks and interdisciplinary teams. In place of learning to speak foreign languages, students carry out computer information searches and become fluent in the use of computers. As data banks replace the encyclopedia, usefulness emerges as the highest value. Interdisciplinarity and teamwork become “nature for the postmodern man” (PMC 51-2).

In science, the question of legitimacy serves as the driving force for the renewal of scientific discourse and the replacement of each generation of scientists. In support of this, determinism remains central to scientific aims, but deterministic predictions require knowledge of variables. Classical mechanics satisfy the demand for events on the human scale that move in continuous, orderly, and predictable patterns. This is not the case for microscopic quantum particles whose position and momentum are uncertain so that knowledge of present states yields only probable knowledge of future states. Catastrophe theory and complexity theory further muddy the water of determinism. Isabel Stengers and Ilya Prigogine’s (1984) theory of an evolutionary universe, consisting of dissipative systems, irreversibility, and non-equilibrium mechanics contributed significantly to limiting the sphere of deterministic natural events.

Lyotard concludes that these scientific developments imply that science has evolved to the point where it no longer produces knowledge. Few scientists would agree with this judgment, and fewer still would likely characterize their methods as “paralogy”, reasoning which contradicts logic. Lyotard identifies paralogy with the unpredictability of postmodern science. He ascribes this to the philosopher of science Paul Feyerabend’s (1970) anti-method epistemological anarchism, which includes open systems and local determinism. Searching for a validation principle, Lyotard turns to Niklas Luhmann (1995, [1984]) whose systems theory exhibits paralogy by advocating moves played in the so-called pragmatics of knowledge. This occurs when “someone” disturbs the order of reason within any given paradigm and establishes new rules for a new field of research of the language games of science. The result is discoveries that are unpredictable and only locally determinable, thus not universalizable. For Lyotard, scientific research neither advocates nor uses this “terrorist” model. In pursuit of performance, decision-makers tend to declare that society is ignorant of its needs. Yet in modern scientific research, every case is open and subject to possible revision. Interesting statements are those that depart from what is already known and so generate additional game rules.

The rules governing the statements of the pragmatics of science referring to their objects of study follow the appropriate moves of scientific language games. They impose a method that allows them to generate new ideas, but all social systems do not operate alike. The universal consensus is dismissed for presupposing an impossible universal validity for the pragmatics of social life. Universal rules are viewed as outmoded and suspect, at most an end and not a process, leaving the idea and practice of justice unresolved. The pragmatics of science must be differentiated from social language games which deviate from norms. For example, if the society renounces terror, local moves must be agreed to by players who accept the reality of certain uses of language that lead to actions in a specific space and time. The social contract can then be accepted as a temporary contract extending to all social and institutional domains, but must remain ambiguous and impure. The necessity that players assume responsibility for rules and their effects is frequently ignored. Currently, computerization can either contribute to the instantiation of terror or support meta-prescriptions by supplying information and giving the public free access to data banks and computer memory. In principle, this can satisfy the desire for justice and yet unknown actions. However, it raises the serious question of whether it discourages individual and group responsibility.

5. The Limits of Postmodern Communication

Given the divergent rules of social systems, conflicts seem inevitable, especially if they are subject to a single rule of judgment. In The Differend: Phrases in Dispute (1988 [1983]), Lyotard defines this term by asking under what conditions a rule and a judgment produce a wrong. If a universal rule of judgment between heterogeneous parties, situations, or genres is lacking, how can conflicts between parties be resolved, in whose favor, and under what principles? Not only currently, but in disputes going back to ancient philosophy, phrases (speech acts including linguistic and extra-linguistic events, statements, objects, and so forth) cannot justly be translated into one another. As speech acts, they exist in the world and affect it. Genres of discourse link phrases to persuade, convince, vanquish, make laugh or cry, and so forth. But it remains doubtful that rules (regimens) governing reasoning, knowing, describing, recounting, questioning, showing, and ordering can link heterogeneous phrases. What happens when this kind of difference or heterogeneity, which Lyotard refers to as the differend, occurs between two sets of phrases, two genres used by different parties? What philosophical reflection could address the gap between these two ways of speaking and acting to “save the honor of thinking” (TD xii)? The question became crucial in the Postmodern era when formerly marginal groups and individuals began to speak and act publicly using novel methods.

For Lyotard, the task of philosophy is to show that linking these two is problematic and difficult in the discourse outside of philosophy such as economics, exchange, and capital, and the discourse inside philosophy—that of academic mastery. It demands bearing witness to the differend, the difference between what is outside and the inside, because there are stakes tied to every genre of discourse. This is less a conflict between humans than a conflict of phrases, the effect of phrases. Humans are situated in heterogeneous phrase regimens and so are tied to heterogeneous genres of discourse. In language, as Lyotard succinctly points out, attempts to resolve the differend through a supreme genre that encompasses the difference between them are undone by Russell’s paradox, which states that a class of all classes both is and is not included in itself (Irvine and Deutsch 2021). The same can be said of a genre encompassing everything including itself, but then not actually including itself. In other words, the genre that is part of a set of genres cannot be supreme. Thus, any genre of discourse claiming supremacy is making a paradoxical claim. It follows that the claim by capital or modernism or any other genre (especially politics) to encompass other genres is unjust and in vain.

For politics and philosophy, this situation is characterized by the victimization of interlocutors by language understood as communication. There always appears to be a residue of differends, conflicts that cannot be regulated by any idiom. Without new addresses, new addressors, new signification, and new referents, wrongs cannot be discussed and corrected. Furthermore, plaintiffs (those who lodge a complaint and request restitution or remuneration within a given set of rules or a genre of discourse) usually become victims. Conflicts will always be regulated in the idiom of one party, which does not recognize the harm or wrong suffered by the other. As a result, no tribunal can recognize a victim, which constitutes them as victims. For Lyotard, the process does not start with the differend being put into phrases but is signaled by a feeling, the sense that one cannot find the right words immediately so new idioms are needed. These new idioms begin with silence, that is, with the recognition that what needs to be phrased exceeds what can currently be phrased. This is illustrated by victims of the Holocaust who did not see the inside of the gas chambers and are therefore refused the designation of “plaintiff” when confronted by Holocaust deniers who narrowly define the applicable terms. This is also the case for the labor power of the undocumented laborer who does not exist within the idiom of bourgeois social and economic law.

Lyotard’s commitment to saving the honor of thinking has been overlooked by philosophers and non-philosophers eager to reinstate metanarratives, as much as by those who embrace the conflict inherent in the differend. He is clear that genocide or terror cannot be justified or even represented, as any representation is already a misrepresentation. Yet he maintains that the incommensurability of regimens does not condemn philosophers to silence. Human historical-political progress may be incapable of direct presentation but stands as an object of Ideas of Reason according to the schema specified by Immanuel Kant (1724-1804). For Kant, reason is the highest human faculty, and its ideas meet with nothing in our experience. Instead, they are thought only in the mode of “as-if.” We think and act as if the ideas of reason are possible in experience. This means that the referent of the feeling Lyotard proposes is still to come. He argues the referent will also have to be a different feeling from the one that inaugurated the differend, calling this feeling enthusiasm. Lyotard maintains that it is impossible to have a sensible or empirical representation of terror. In place of the experience of a feeling arising from conflict, the philosopher can engage with the feeling of non-reconciliation. This would be the pleasure of displeasure, the incommensurability of the sensibility with the ideas of reason, and the anticipation of a phrase still to come. Enthusiasm must remain undetermined regarding time and so cannot be subordinate to mechanical causation. Neither a cause nor an effect, this event is an index, the sign of history that recalls, shows, and anticipates, presenting only free causality. For Lyotard, given the human predisposition to speculative reason, this mode of thinking, this enthusiasm, is already progress.

The potential for communicability between parties begins with the experience of the original feeling of conflict. It is an effect of the Kantian idea of the beautiful, the phrase of good taste, insofar as Kant argued that an appreciation of the beautiful requires good taste. Although one cannot find words for it, in principle appreciation remains possible. Enthusiasm, however, is a modality of the feeling of the sublime, a feeling of respect. It arises from the pain of the incapacity to present a solution to the differend and the joy in discovering that the latter, as part of nature, is exceeded by the ideas of reason. Thus, the passage between conflicting genres is the impasse akin to the prohibition against attempting to represent the unrepresentable. Enthusiasm, aesthetically sublime and so indeterminate, exists beyond the bounds of sensibility. It is an impulse of the mind exceeding any sensible representation—formless and without empirical validation. Enthusiasm, Lyotard offers, encompasses the potentially universal idea of a communal sense, an ideal but indeterminate norm, a sentimental anticipation. It is the as-if presentation of the idea of a society free of national and local prejudices and imbued with the idea of a communal morality, both of which exist only in the idea and for which only indirect presentations will ever be found.

6. Rorty and The Broken Mirror

The American philosopher Richard Rorty offers a contrary approach to language games and social consensus. Rorty (1979) asserts the equality of all language games, ostensibly operating within the confines of his metanarrative. He begins with the demand for the elimination of epistemology as the search for foundations that constrain and frame and so cause conflict between language games. He then argues for replacing epistemology with a version of hermeneutics, defined as an expression of his objection to sets of rules that lay out how to reach rational agreement. The work of epistemology, as Rorty sees it, is to find maximal common ground with others, but in so doing he finds that it creates conflict. His goal of reducing conflict is somewhat like Lyotard’s project, yet it operates by other means. The practitioner of hermeneutics intervenes in conflicting language games and carries out the job of an “informed dilettante”, mediating between various incommensurable discourses and hoping for agreement or fruitful and exciting disagreement (PMN 317). Rorty characterizes most of what this requires as translation, which he attributes to physicalism (the idea that everything is ultimately physical). Persons capable of carrying out mediation are united in a societas; they are persons united by civility, although it seems there is nothing more than this uniting them.

Rorty sets the most blame for the epistemological view on the shoulders of Descartes and Kant: Descartes, whose demand for cognitive certainty produces the separation of body and mind, and Kant, whose transcendental philosophy claims that knowledge of the world is an inner mental representation. Rorty eliminates these two by embracing anti-dualism. According to anti-dualism, as Donald Davidson advocates, beliefs and their referents are not two separate phenomena. He also takes up what he calls the anti-essentialist pragmatism of John Dewey who argued that the human organism physically adapts to its environment.

However, even hermeneutics must initially operate with some discourse. Rorty refers to this as “normal” discourse by analogy with Thomas Kuhn’s (1962) concept of “normal science”, defined as an agreed upon set of conventions or the conceptual scheme “of our own culture”, a normative conventional discourse (PMN 324). Presumably what is normal is some version of standardized English as used by philosophers. It is not a “language of unified science” that contains everything anyone could say, but “neutral – if unhelpful observations language” (PMN 349). Hermeneutics must also take account of “abnormal” discourse—the failure to either know or follow normal conventions. It does so from the point of view of normal discourse, which it initially takes for granted. What is abnormal may be in the eye of the beholder, and Rorty works to clarify this point.

Rorty’s restrictions on discourse extend to the terms “objective” and “cognitive.” He characterizes these terms as products of the mirrored world of rational belief understood as correspondence to the real. He claims they are part of the wished-for agreement among inquirers in morality, physics, and psychology. Even more debatable, for Rorty, are the disciplines of chemistry, literary criticism, and sociology, whose signifiers are non-cognitive or merely operational terms. It becomes clear that his epistemological behaviorism is about agreements between persons charged with moral feeling, a consequence of Enlightenment values, which Rorty personally feels are justified (PMN 335).

For the cohort of agreeable persons on the other side of the epistemological binary, the term “subjective” refers only to something unfamiliar to that cohort. It can reveal nothing about what it means for an individual as this aspect of the term appears to have been swept away, leaving only references to cohort behavior. Personal considerations are illogical, whether historical, physiological, psychological, and so forth. They have withered away with anti-representationalism and the smashing of the mirror of nature. Rorty does not hesitate to wave aside the discourse of the mentally impaired or those he considers unintelligent and to account for their intentions and actions without consulting them by basing it on “our science” (PMN 349).

This is amplified by Rorty’s criticism of a hypothetical transcendental self, which he defines as a self that functions as a moral and epistemological agent constituting a phenomenal world. This world is structured largely by the mind, specifically the a priori categories of understanding, a position attributed to Kant. Of course, if one does not find coherent generalizations and categories in nature, one cannot simply create them. There must be a constant parallel between nature and knowledge of nature. Thus, Rorty cites the need for some constants. Only nature and matter, the subjects of physics, provide a stable background for stories about historical change more commonly attributed to moral law or poetry. Rorty’s “naturalism” gradually emerges, as it is the ability to predict others’ future behavior rather than the meaning of their discourse that dominates his thinking. It is also because he believes physics is a deterministic science that will eventually have the capacity to predict every aspect of human and animal behavior. There is no point in claiming that a person alters themselves in any respect through self-reflection when in fact they are altering themselves through a change of diet or sexual partner. It is not merely that there is no difference between nature and what he refers to as “spirit”. Rather, he argues that the latter is best explicated in terms of the former to ensure the non-emergence of spirit or mind as constituting or creating phenomenal reality. Ultimately, Rorty seeks to decisively eliminate epistemology as the activity of spirit once and for all.

7. Baudrillard’s Logic of Simulation

Breaking the mirror of nature is not celebrated unequivocally by all postmodern thinkers. Jean Baudrillard does not embrace the loss of the magic and charm of the real, nor the passing of the equivalence of the sign and the real. In Simulacra and Simulation (1994 [1981]), he agrees that there is “[n]o more mirror of being and appearances, of the real and its concept” (SS 2). The consequences of this transition are rather different from those Rorty predicted. Representation, Baudrillard argues, at least attempted to define simulation as a false representation and so absorbed it. But simulation on its own envelops any representation as just another simulacrum. The real truly becomes merely operational and is no longer real at all. All referentials, terms applied to specific phenomena, are liquidated, then artificially resurrected in another system, the system of signs where they cease to refer to specifics and often play the role of metaphors. The simulation process threatens, if not destroys, all distinctions between true and false, real and imaginary. The disappearance is orderly, as the image, the representation, passes through several phases. First, it reflects a profound reality, but then it strips away its defining characteristics. It masks its absence and eliminates any relation to reality. Finally, it becomes pure simulacrum, pure imitation. As it transitions, the image proceeds from a sacramental good appearance to a maleficent evil one, to the sorcery of a play of appearance to pure simulation—from something to nothing.

The many entanglements of the simulacrum are profoundly evident to Louis Marin in the Disneyland amusement park. Discussed initially in his essay “Disneyland, A Degenerate Utopia” (1977) as symptomatic of the society of control, Marin describes Disneyland as a logistically constituted illusion that masks itself as a site of freedom and equality. He argues it serves a much more disturbing function:

[I]t has become dedicated to the production of consumable collective images, which create and maintain the system of ideas and values used by social, political, and economic forces to maintain their dominance and somewhat secondarily, to promulgate their values, since ‘values’ are only in service to dominance (TRR 184).

Baudrillard affirms this, adding that the reason Disneyland is imaginary is to convince us the rest of America is real. For him, the rest is hyperreal; it is the effect of “the generation of models of a real without origin or reality”, a representation without a referent (SS 14). The child’s imaginary world of Disneyland is everywhere in America. Baudrillard states that many cities like Los Angeles and even all of California are immense scenarios recycling what he theorizes is the typical American imaginary of children and adults, the toxic waste of a hyperreal civilization. For this reason, the world outside of Disneyland is no different from the world inside. It is overrun by sexual, psychic, and somatic “institutes” that recycle lost faculties, bodies, sociality, and the lost taste for food in the form of natural and health food.

Baudrillard refers to this as the logic of simulation in which models precede facts, essentially doing away with them. These models, or simulacra, circulate and constitute a magnetic field and make simultaneous and contradictory interpretations possible, which appear true due to the subtle and elusive twisting of meaning. The logic of simulation effectively conjoins a system to its extreme alternative like two sides of a curved mirror. Baudrillard cites the conjoining of the political left to the political right, desire to value, capital, and law. As Gilles Deleuze and Félix Guattari have claimed, desire is found to want its own repression and its investment in paranoid (isolated) and fascist (authoritarian) systems, due to the conjoining of desire with value, capital, or law, (1983 [1972]).

The logic of simulation shows itself in numerous forms such as that of the panopticon, a system of constant surveillance, which has infiltrated what it once was meant to survey. Likewise, the neutral, implosive violence of systems of deterrence have infiltrated the threat of nuclear terror, serving as a pretext for even more sophisticated weapons. Space exploration, Baudrillard claims, was always a cover-up for “satellization”, the deployment of information-gathering satellites driven by programming and technical manipulation. He sees them operating to “model vectors of a system of planetary control”, which included securing the non-intervention of China in Vietnam and the rapid withdrawal of American forces once this was assured (SS 34). Novelist George Orwell’s concept of “war is peace” was thus verified as part of a series of artificial occurrences initiated to maintain the illusion of actuality—“wag the dog”, as it is called in the movies.

8. The Great Trauma of Postmodern Thought, Deterrence, and the Implosion of Meaning

The great trauma of Baudrilliard’s era is the decline of strong referentials, which represents the death pangs of the real and the rational and results in fetishizing the most recent eras and events of real history to the complete indifference of spectators. This is evident in cinema, a “hot” medium, says Marshall McLuhan (1977), which plagiarizes earlier versions of itself and loses all relation to the imaginary. For example, the Vietnam-era film Apocalypse Now (1979) hits its viewers primarily with the horror of filmmaking in place of the horror of the actual Vietnam War. Television, a “cold” medium in McLuhan’s terms, acts as another deterrent. The cold light of television mesmerizes the viewer and transistorizes their neurons. Yet, it is unable to produce even an image from its studios that resembles the control centers of nuclear power reactors. Therefore, the televised media-driven accounts of near-nuclear reactor meltdowns transforms the hot power of destruction into the cold power of deterrence and the simulation of catastrophe. The only possible mitigation comes from an act of God or terrorists, both of whom can produce real, palpable violence.

Commensurate with these events is the circular relationship between information and meaning. Following the hypothesis put forth by Claude Shannon (1949), information operates as a purely functional code without relation to meaning. Baudrillard reformulates this to argue that information is also exhausted through staging, that is, by inviting participants to join the simulation of communication. It lures them into something they do not fully believe is real. The medium seduces them, despite its myth-like, indecipherable message concerning the real and the dissipation of its power. This makes the media akin to a terrorist operation, carrying the simulation internal to the social system and that which destroys it. At the precise moment when the media urges the masses to take up the active subject position of freedom, emancipation, expression, or politics, they are equally subject to the object position renouncing practices of the subject and renouncing meaning in their alienation and passivity.

9. Seizing Reality and Embracing Nihilism

The renunciation of meaning is evident in advertising, defined by the convergence of the economic, the political, and eventually, the social. Advertising functions as a matter of supply and demand and as an extension of propaganda, Baudrillard’s zero degree of meaning. He argues that Las Vegas, where advertising effaces all architecture, streets, and walls, absorbing everything onto the surface in a mockery of all signs, exemplifies this.

Similarly, cloning purges the genetic code of the uncertainty of sex. It is the site where the body becomes a message, serially reproducible like a cancer. The mind is no different, able to be psychotropically modeled from inside—without perspectival representation, mirror or discourse required. The three-dimensional hologram tracks the imaginary aura of the double, allowing the passing through of one’s ghostly body like an unborn dead twin, extracting the imaginary, synthesizing and materializing it. No longer an image, it is another hyperreality, a three-dimensional simulacrum, the “luminous ectoplasm of your own body” (SS 105). For Baudrillard, such technology is now an extension of the body as in J.G. Ballard’s novel Crash (1973), which he calls the first great novel of simulation—neither fiction nor reality. The novel describes functionalist machines (automobiles), functional sexuality, language, and the body, fused and confused with technology in its violating and violent dimensions. The advent of technological hyperreality makes it likely that Ballard’s novel is no longer science fiction, a genre Baudrillard declares is over because it is no longer possible to even conceive of an alternative universe in a world where technology has no bounds.

Baudrillard reminds the reader that animals once had a more sacred and divine character than humans and were thought worthy of being sacrificed as gods. Now, he concludes, “we have made of them a racially inferior world” (SS 130). They are no longer worthy of justice, only of sentimentality (as pets), nor are they worthy of punishment, only experimentation in laboratories and subject to extermination for consumption (SS 130). Like children and the so-called “mad” and “primitives”, animals do not speak, yet their silence weighs on those who do. They are made to serve as models of unreason and metaphors for virtue and vice, ecological systems, artificial intelligence, and the “phantasmatic register of the unconscious” (SS 135). Most paradoxical is animal-becoming as the model of deterritorialization or displacement of desire, the productive power of all forms of life. Because the animal is the most territorial creature of all and its territory is open and circumscribed, it has become the site of animal and vegetal cycles, parentage and species, women and ritual, exchange and not death.

Finally, there is Baudrillard, the self-proclaimed nihilist accepting the radical destruction of appearances, the disenchantment of the world, and its abandonment to violence and interpretation. Baudrillard endorses nihilism without the nostalgia associated with it by cultural theorists like Theodore Adorno and Walter Benjamin. Thus, birth, death, value, sexuality, the social, and the real are remainders left behind by the rupture of alliances and the stockpile of repressed effects and representations. Even the universities are sites of the remainder—functioning only as zones for the shelter and surveillance of a certain class or a certain age of human, the youth. Against the system’s hegemony, Baudrillard advocates certain small reversals, such as the ruses of desire, the quotidian, even cooking. For him, however, even this fails. Imperiously checking (not ending) the system in broad daylight, anything carried out by either theoretical or real violence is hopeless.

10. The Arts and The Ruin of Representation

Without irony, postmodernism is not one singular line of thought. There is a postmodern nihilation of modernism, a reactionary postmodernism, and a postmodernism of resistance, although none preclude other versions of postmodernism. The word “postmodernist” was reportedly used first by the art critic Leo Steinberg in his essay “Other Criteria” (1972) and later appeared in his book by the same name. It was used to describe works of art, specifically “a picture conceived as an image of an image” (OC 91). Such an image guarantees that no image will be presented as a real-world space, and so it allows “any experience” to be the content of its representation. Significantly, it belongs to a shakeup that goes far beyond works of art to anything that “contaminates purified categories” (OC 91). Thus, postmodernism is not limited to art, and anything may now move into strange territories and abandon the long-established “stand-by criteria”, the typical standards of evaluation (OC 91). This version of postmodern resistance is powered by the turn from purely theoretical constructs to cultural and artistic ones, which in many instances precede their theoretical siblings.

Rosalind Krauss (1983) maintains that postwar American art kneaded, stretched, and twisted the categories of sculpture and painting with enormous elasticity in the name of the new. Nevertheless, its covert message was historicism, diminishing newness and mitigating difference. She argues that the logic of sculptural monumentality began to fail by the late 19^th century when the work of Rodin and Balzac became siteless. This made it suitable in any museum or cultural context because it was abstract and self-referential, embodying modernist negativity without positive cultural content. Krauss claims the idealist space was exhausted by the 1950s. Despite Frederick Jameson and Baudrillard’s protests that the postmodern emerged as nothing more than pastiche, for many it was an expression of the social order of late capitalism. It embodied the dangerous, explosive, subversive aspects of modernism and the hyperrealism of simulations, the great advertising screens, to which many theorists and artists objected.

Edward Said (1983) famously criticized Jameson for endorsing the discontinuity of a global perspective with local alliances. He argued that Jameson advocated a strong hermeneutic globalism, a Marxism that subsumes the local into the larger context and thereby abandons the “extra-academic world” to the politics of the new right and Reaganism. This left a small yet humane function to the humanities, which could only represent a humane marginality. They served the preservation and concealment of the hierarchy of powers that occupy the center, define the social terrain, and fix the limits of use functions, fields, and marginality.

For the art theorist and critic Craig Owens (1983), this is evidence that Paul Ricoeur (1914-2005) was correct in observing that the discovery of a plurality of cultures is never harmless. Plurality puts into question the hegemony of Western culture and exposes the system of power that authorizes some representations and blocks others. Out of this plurality, the psychoanalyst Michel Montrelay (1978) identified women as the “ruin of representation”, exposing women as the blindspot in the discussion of postmodernism. Montrelay asserts that the ruin of representation refers to the unconscious representation of women as objects, which, unlike conscious representation, no longer refers to anything—it is just words removed from reality, no more than a text.

Referring to Montrelay, Owens argues male theorists like Jameson tried to neutralize the issues women placed on a critical agenda by subverting them to concerns about class. While Lyotard objected on behalf of postmodernism to the “grand recits”, the master narratives of modernity, it is the artist Mary Kelly who pragmatically catalogued the period from her child’s birth up to age five in her work “Post-Partum Document” (1973-1979), and so she rejects and refutes the reduction of all narratives to a single grand story, whether it is about motherhood or female artists. Another of Kelly’s works, Interim (1984-89), documents a series of Kelly’s conversations with women in various social settings. She situates these discussions in terms of three categories: body (corpus), money (pecunia), history (historia), and power (potentia). Emblematic of this method, the images and conversations about the category “body” personify the five passionate attitudes of “hysterical” women photographed by the French neurologist Jean Charcot (1825-1893). Charcot, Sigmund Freud’s Parisian mentor, treated the women in his care with hypnotism. Charcot’s photographic subjects (who may have been imitating the hysterics with whom they were housed) and Kelly’s images, make what she calls “a play dedicated to the production of unreason as a tangible event” a visible spectacle (OI 57).

Kelly was not the first feminist artist to work against tradition and stereotype. Her work contradicts the claim that artworks presenting “an image of an image” are removed from reality. Along with Kelly, multiple feminist performance and body artists took advantage of the plasticity of human personality made possible by the malleability of surfaces and appearances. Their art made use of self-referentiality to situate themselves as subjects and to expose their realities. Martha Rosler’s Semiotics of the Kitchen (1974/75) uses the sign system of domesticity—kitchen utensils. She names them in her performance, abstractly demonstrating their function with increasing ferocity while remaining impassive. Rosler has described this work as a postmodern image of TV culture and celebrated male chefs, while the language and objects of the kitchen reduce women to domesticity.

Valie Export’s “Women’s Art” manifesto (1972) set out the parameters for women artists shaping their own image in the work of art as an act of resistance. She theorizes that the mythology of male values allows “men [to] create and control the social and communication media such as science and art, word and image, fashion and architecture, social transportation and division of labor” (AW 187). Export demonstrates that her most important material was the female body used as a code or sign, her performances usually being performed fully or partially nude. To challenge pornographic/erotic elements, she exposed body parts including her breasts or genitals to be seen or touched while the rest of her body remained hidden. These acts always took place in the presence of attendees in the public sphere. Export directly observed each person who approached or touched her, returning their gaze. Non-sexualized parts of the body were covered or placed in a shocking context such as rolling over broken glass to deny the expected erotic bodily sign to the male gaze. Other significant postmodern feminist performance artists include Carolee Schneeman, Karen Finley, and Diamanda Galas.

Cultural studies scholar Meaghan Morris (1988) calls attention to the “sense of intrigue” that developed around the absence or withholding of “women’s speech” in discussions of postmodernism (TPF 376). She points to male counterparts who speculated that postmodernism was not pertinent to feminist concerns, admitting at best to the intersection of feminism and postmodernism. Morris asks under what conditions women’s work can figure in postmodernism other than being appropriately framed by male theorists’ discourse. She asserts the necessity of reclaiming women’s work and their names in the context of postmodern debates. This is necessary because an “overwhelmingly male pantheon of proper names” taken up as “ritual objects of academic exegesis and commentary” has successfully constituted postmodernism (TPF 378). Thus, she sees the occasional inclusion of women artists and theorists—by Owens and others—as token acts. The recognition of artists and theorists acknowledged to be postmodern but still not engaged with in the literature of postmodernism reenacts the “(feminized) object-language and a (masculine) meta-language” divide (TPF 379). It is precisely this type of division that has been brought into question by feminist scholarship, which has to be seen and read before it can be used.

11. The Architecture of Multivalence

The public visibility of architecture contributed to its extensive role in the practice and discourse of postmodernism. Architectural historian Charles Jencks (1977) points to the July 15, 1972 dynamiting of the Corbusier-inspired Pruitt-Igoe low-income housing development in St. Louis. He declares it the end of uninhabitable modernism and the beginning of postmodernism in architecture. An articulate spokesperson for postmodern architecture, Jencks argues that what is notable about postmodern buildings is they speak to both the professional architect and the public concerned with comfort and tradition. Critical especially of Robert Venturi, whom he judged could not reconcile opposing meanings within his buildings, Jencks advocates for the architectural language he called “radical eclecticism” (LPA 87). With this new language, a variety of styles could form a semantically justified creative synthesis that is at once variegated and witty, messy and ordered. To execute this effectively the architect had to work in at least two directions and train in more than one style, to the point of developing a kind of stylistic schizophrenia.

Jencks sets out canons for production and preconditions for creativity, which he calls “emergent rules”. Not all these rules can be universally practiced; notably, they include principles of dissonant beauty or disharmonious harmony. Cultural and political pluralism justifies these apparent contradictions. They are realized in buildings that manifest a long list of characteristics: urban contextualism that fits into the street; anthropomorphic moldings and ornaments suggestive of the human body; parody, nostalgia, or pastiche with respect to past architectural styles; pluralistic content and signification or intertextuality; double-coding through irony, ambiguity, and contradiction; multivalence with respect to the environment; dramatic reinterpretation of tradition; new rhetorical figures or signs; and the absence of a center. Jencks states that every style is possible due to modern methods of fabrication and new modes of communication and scholarship. These canons remain subject to evolution, and the architecture they create can still be subject to dead-ends, imbalances, and urban problems.

Possibly first among the architects embracing the postmodern turn are Robert Venturi, Denise Scott-Brown, and Steven Izenour, whose book Learning From Las Vegas (1972) celebrated the style of suburban strip malls, Las Vegas casinos, and billboards. Their designs culminated in the “decorated shed”, using signs and images taken from popular culture in place of the architectural forms championed by the modernist Bauhaus (CCA 87). Venturi argues for complexity and contradiction in architecture, and by this he means to include complexity of meaning—derived from interior characteristics and context and perceptual ambiguity and tension (LFL 16). He likens this to Kurt Gödel’s (1906-1978) proof of inconsistency in mathematics. It is an inclusivity that does not separate architecture from the experience of life and the needs of society. The elements of a building defined by the inclusive “tradition of both-and” make it possible for a single feature to occupy multiple functions even if it produces spaces that are good and bad, as long as they exist for the sake of the whole (LFL 23).

Venturi discovers these characteristics in architecture throughout its history. For example, he notes that even the apparent aesthetic simplicity of a Doric temple is only achieved through the subtleties and precision found in its distorted geometry, which give rise to the contradictions and tensions inherent in its apparent order. Venturi was much admired for his original ideas regarding architecture and popular culture. Yet, paradoxically, he also argued that architects should narrow their concerns and focus only on architecture rather than cultural change. Some criticized his concept and his focus on the creation of architectural functional boxes as supporting the ugly and banal. Despite his claim to plurality, Venturi ultimately made no effort to include Scott-Brown when he was awarded architecture’s Pritzker Prize in 1991.

12. The End of Postmodernism in Astral America

The theoretical and visual aspects of postmodernism converge explicitly in Baudrillard’s America (1988 [1986]), a text signaling the fulfillment and the dénouement of the postmodern condition. For the French intellectual, it is the journey from postmodern theory to postmodern reality. Baudrillard discovers the America of Venturi-Scott-Brown, the aesthetically sublime landscape envisioned by Lyotard, the indeterminate that is beyond the bounds of sensibility, the impulse of the mind exceeding sensible representation, and the formless, existing without validation. From the perspective of America, Europe simply disappears. Astral, from the Ancient Greek ἄστρον (star), refers in theosophy to the supersensible substance of the sensible realm. Baudrillard reveals the astral America of open freeways, deserts, motels, and minerals. He finds the America of the affectless succession of signs and images that can be understood only by traveling its physical and mental deserts. This aspect of America is the reality of the postmodern for Baudrillard, actualizing the “inhumanity of our ulterior, asocial, superficial world [which] immediately finds its aesthetic form here, its ecstatic form” in its critique of culture and the ecstatic form of disappearance (A 5).

Despite the desert’s silence and its luminous, fossilized network of inhuman intelligence, it is, for Baudrillard, the site of the society of complexity, hybridity, and intermingling. These are terms usually attributed to the postmodern and its alleged extermination of meaning. It is where the land, faces, and things are just what they are and nothing more. Baudrillard finds America to be the real hyperreality, the perfect simulacrum, whose inhabitants are the models for all simulation. Its culture arises in relation to the deserts, thus empty and radically nude. It is not the high culture familiar to visitors to Europe, not the old world, but a whole chasm of modernity, a simulation of culture that is a mirage. Its towns without centers and its nightlife take place on the strips where cars cruise up and down. It takes time for Baudrillard to adjust, yet eventually he concedes that the deserts are exemplary sites that banish sociality, sentimentality, and sexuality; they are the first places where words and intellect have no meaning. In the sublime beauty of Death Valley, Baudrillard finally revels in its pastel colors, soft air, and mineral light. Akin to an alien planet, it is the sign of 180 million years making plain the enigma of his own existence and the likelihood of humanity’s disappearance, which is quite possibly postmodernity’s ultimate prediction.

13. References and Further Reading

Appignanesi, Lisa. ed. Postmodernism, ICA Documents. London: Free Association Books, 1989.
Ballard, J.G. Crash. New York: Fourth Estate, 1973.
Baudrillard, 1994, Simulacra and Simulation. trans. Sheila Faria Glaser Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press. Simulacres et simulation, Editions Galilee, 1981. Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press. (SS)
Baudrillard, Jean. America. trans. Chris Turner. London: Verso, 2010. Amériqu. Paris: Grasset 1986.
Bell, Daniel. The Cultural Contradictions of Capitalism. New York: Basic Books, 1976. (CCC)
Beville, Kieran. “Understanding Postmodernism, A Preliminary Discussion of Issues Pertaining to the Feasibility of the Homiletic Task in the Contemporary Epistemological Context”. in Preaching Christ in a Postmodern Culture. Cambridge UK: Cambridge Scholars Publishing, 2011. (UPM)
Black, Max. “Wittgenstein’s Language-games”. Dialectica. Vol. 33, No. 3/4 (1979): 337-53. (WLG)
Boolos, George. “Introductory Note to 1951 Gibbs lecture”. Kurt Gödel 1995: 290–304.
Collected Works III. Unpublished Essays and Lectures, S. Feferman et al. (eds.). Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Deleuze, Gilles, and Félix Guattari. Anti-Oedipus. trans. Robert Hurley, Mark Seem, and Helen R. Lane. Vol. 1 of Capitalism and Schizophrenia. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1983. Originally published as L’anti-Oedipe: Capitalisme et Schizophrénie. Paris: Minuit, 1972.
Export, Vallie. “Interview”. Juno, A. and Vale V. (eds.) Re/Search 13. Angry Women, San Francisco: Re/Search Publications: 1991, 186-93. (AW)
Feyerabend, Paul, K. Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1991.
Foster, Hal. The Anti-Aesthetic, Essays on Postmodern Culture. Seattle: Bay Press, 1983. (AA)
Foucault, Michel. The Order of Things. trans. Alan Sheridan. London: Routledge, 1970. Les mots et les choses. Paris: Gallimard, 1966.
Habermas, Jürgen. “Modernity—An Incomplete Project”, in Hal Foster (ed.) The Anti-Aesthetic, Essays on Postmodern Culture, Seattle: Bay Press, 1983. (MIP)
Harvey, David. The Condition of the Postmodern, An Enquiry into the Origins of Cultural Change. Cambridge and Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 1990. (TCP)
Hassan, Ihab. The Postmodern Turn, Essays in Postmodern Theory and Culture. Ohio State University Press, 1987. (TPT)
Huyssen, Andreas. “Mapping the Postmodern”. New German Critique. No. 33. Modernity and Postmodernity. Autumn (1984):5-52. (MP)
Jameson, Fredric. “The Cultural Logic of Late Capitalism”. New Left Review. 146 (July/Aug 1984): 53-92. (CLL)
Jencks, Charles. The Language of Postmodern Architecture. New York: Rizzoli, 1977. (LPA)
Kelly, Mary. “Re-Presenting the Body: On Interim, Part I”. in Psychoanalysis and Cultural Theory: Thresholds. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1986. (OI)
Krauss, Rosalind. “Sculpture in the Expanded Field”. Hal Foster. ed. The Anti-Aesthetic, Essays on Postmodern Culture. Seattle: Bay Press, 1983. (AA)
Kuhn, Thomas. M. The Structure of Scientific Revolutions. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1962.
Luhmann, Niklas. Social Systems Writing Science. Redwood City: Stanford University Press, 1996.
Lyotard, Jean-François. The Postmodern Condition: A Report on Knowledge. trans. Geoff Bennington and Brian Massumi. Manchester: Manchester University Press. 1984. La Condition post-moderne: rapport sur le savoir. Paris: Minuit, 1979. (PMC)
Lyotard, Jean-François. The Differend: Phrases in Dispute. trans. Georges Van Den Abbeele, Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1988. Le Différend, Paris: Minuit, 1983. (TD)
Marin, Louis. “Disneyland: A Degenerate Utopia”. Glyph: Johns Hopkins Textual Studies. Vol. 1. (March 1977): 50–66. (DU)
McLuhan, Marshall. The Medium is the Massage. Berkeley, CA: Gingko Press, 2001.
Montrelay, Michele. “Inquiry into Femininity”. m/f no. 1. (1978): 83-101. (IF)
Morris, Meaghan. The Pirates Fiancée. New York and London: Verso Books, 1988. (TPF)
Olkowski, Dorothea. Postmodern Philosophy and the Scientific Turn. Indiana University Press, 2012.
Olkowski, Dorothea. Gilles Deleuze and The Ruin of Representation, University of California Press, 1999.
Olkowski, Dorothea. The Universal (In the Realm of the Sensible). Edinburgh and New York: Edinburgh University Press and Columbia University Press co-publication, 2007. (URS)
Owens, Craig. “The Discourse of Others: Feminists and Postmodernism”. Hal Foster. ed. The Anti-Aesthetic, Essays on Postmodern Culture, Seattle: Bay Press, 1983. (DO)
Poli, Francesco. Postmodern Art, from the Post-War to Today, New York: Harper Collins, 2008.
Rorty, Richard. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1979. (PMN)
Rosler, Martha, “Semiotics of the Kitchen”. NY: Electronic Arts Intermix, 1975. https://edan.si.edu/saam/id/object/2008.21.7
Said, Edward W. “Opponents, Audiences, Constituencies, and Community”. Hal Foster. ed. The Anti-Aesthetic, Essays on Postmodern Culture. Seattle: Bay Press. 1983. (OACC)
Shannon, Claude E. The Mathematical Theory of Communication. Urbana: The University of Illinois Press, 1949. (MTC)
Steinberg, Leo. Other Criteria, Confrontations with Twentieth Century Art. New York: Oxford University Press, 1972. (OC)
Stengers, Isabelle and Ilya Prigogine. Order Out of Chaos, Man’s New Dialogue with Nature. New York: Bantam Books, 1984. (OOC)
Venturi, Robert. Complexity and Contradiction in Architecture. New York: Museum of Modern Art, 1985. (CCA)
Venturi, Robert, Denise Scott-Brown, and Steven Izenour. Learning From Las Vegas. Cambridge: MIT Press, 1972. (LFL)

Author Information

Dorothea E. Olkowski
Email: deolkowski@icloud.com
University of Colorado
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy