Probability and Induction

‘Probability’ is an ambiguous word. In the history of ideas, it has been used with many different senses, giving rise to different concepts of probability. Being associated with games of chance and gambling, death tolls and insurance policies, statistical inferences and the chancy world of modern physics, probabilities have been made susceptible to different interpretations. These interpretations may reflect on probabilities the objectivity of logic or the subjectivity of a person’s belief and lack of knowledge, the frequencies of observed data or the real tendency of a system to yield an outcome. Commonly, but not always, they are considered to be interpretations of the mathematical concept of probability, which by itself and in itself has no empirical meaning. This article attempts to present the different meanings of ‘probability’ and provide an introductory topography of the conceptual landscape. Without trying to provide a history of the idea, historical elements are considered. Also, realizing that an exhaustive treatment would be difficult, we are focusing, mainly, on the discussion of induction and confirmation. The article is intended as a companion to the article on the Problem of Induction (Psillos and Stergiou, 2022), in which Hans Reichenbach’s major contribution to the interpretation of probability theory is discussed.

Elements of Probability Theory and its Interpretations
1. On Mathematical Probability
2. Interpretations of Probability
What is Probability?
Probability as the Logic of Induction
Carnap’s Inductive Logic
Subjective Probability and Bayesianism
Appendices
References and Further reading

1. Elements of Probability Theory and its Interpretations

a. On Mathematical Probability

In the monograph Foundations of the Theory of Probability, first published in German in 1933, the Soviet mathematician A. N. Kolmogorov presented the definitive form of what in the early twenty-first century is regarded as the axiomatization of mathematical probability. The challenge of axiomatization has been set by D. Hilbert in the sixth of his famous twenty-three problems at the beginning of twentieth century (1902) “ to treat in the same manner [as geometry], by means of axioms, those physical sciences in which mathematics plays an important part; in the first rank are the theory of probabilities and mechanics.” Kolmogorov, addressing the problem, developed a theory of probability as a mathematical discipline “from axioms in exactly the same way as Geometry and Algebra” (1933:1). In his axiomatization, probability and other primary concepts, devoid of any empirical meaning, are defined implicitly in terms of consistent and independent axioms in a set-theoretic setting. Thus, modern mathematical probability theory grew within the branch of mathematics called measure theory. Kolmogorov called elementary theory of probability “that part of the theory in which we have to deal with probabilities of only a finite number of events” (ibid). A random event is an element of an event space, the latter being formalized by the set-theoretic concept of field, introduced by Hausdorff in Set Theory (1927). A field is a S non-empty collection of subsets of a given non-empty set Γ that has the following properties:

(a) for every pair of elements, A,B of S, their union, $A\cup B$ , belongs in S;

(b) for every element A of S, its complement with respect to Γ, $A = Γ$ , is in S. In probability theory the set Γ is called sample space. To understand the above formalization, consider the simple example of tossing a die. Let Γ be the set of the six possible outcomes:

E_1, E_2, E_3, E_4, E_5, E_6

The collection S of all subsets of Γ, $2^6 = 64$ :

$\emptyset, \{E_1\}, \{E_2\}, \ldots, \{E_6\},$
$\{E_1, E_2\}, \{E_1, E_3\}, \ldots, \{E_5, E_6\},$
$\{E_1, E_2, E_3\}, \{E_1, E_2, E_4\}, \ldots, \{E_4, E_5, E_6\},$
$\ldots, \{E_1, E_2, E_3, E_4, E_5, E_6\}$

satisfies conditions

(a) and (b); S is a field. The subsets of Γ represent different possibilities that can be realized in tossing a single die: the empty set, ∅, is a random event that represents an impossible happening. The singletons, $\{E_1\}, \{E_2\}, \ldots, \{E_6\}$ , are the elementary events, since any other random event (except ∅) is a disjunction of these events, expressed by taking the set-theoretic union of the respective singletons. Finally, $\Gamma = \{E_1, E_2, E_3, E_4, E_5, E_6\}$ is an event that represents the realization of any possibility. A function from a field S to the set of real numbers, R, p:S→ R, is called a probability function on S, if it satisfies the following axioms: i. $p(A)\geq0$ , for $A\in S$ ; ii. $p(Γ)= 1$ ; $p(A\cup B)= p( A)+ p(B)$

iii. A∩ B= ∅, for; In the simple example of tossing a die, a probability function p would assign a non-zero real number $p(E)$ to each element E of S, according to axiom (i). Axiom (ii) requires that the random event which describes any possible outcome has probability 1, $p(Γ)= 1$ . Axiom (iii), commonly called finite additivity property, tells us how to calculate the probability value of any random event from the probability values of elementary events, for instance, $p(\{E_1, E_2, E_3, E_4\}) = p(\{E_1, E_2\}) + p(\{E_3, E_4\}) = p(\{E_1\}) + p(\{E_2\}) + p(\{E_3\}) + p(\{E_4\})$ . Notice that there are infinitely many admissible probability functions on the event space of the tossing of a die and that only one of them corresponds to a fair die, the one with $p(\{E_i\}) = \frac{1}{6}$ . Problems concerning a countably infinite number of random events require an additional axiom and the formalization of the event space as a σ-field. A field S is a σ -field if and only if it satisfies the following condition:

(c) for every infinite sequence of elements of S, $\{A_n\}_{n \in \mathbb{N}}$ , the countably infinite union of these sets, $\bigcup_{n=1}^{\infty} A_n$ belongs in S. Every field S of finite cardinality is a σ-field, since any infinite sequence in S consists of a finite number of different subsets of Γ and their union is always in S, according to (a). Yet this may not be the case if the field is constructed from a Γ countably infinite set Γ. Imagine, for instance, a die of infinite faces, where the set of possible outcomes is $E_1, E_2, E_3, \ldots$ Let the collection S consist of subsets A of Γ, which are either of finite cardinality or their complement, is of finite cardinality: $A = Γ$ $S = \{A \subset \Gamma : A \text{ is finite or } \overline{A} \text{ is finite}\}$ . S It is easy to show that is a field. Yet it is not a σ -field, since the set $n\in N$ $\bigcup_{n \in \mathbb{N}} \{E_{2n}\}$ , which is the infinite union of $\{E_{2n}\}$ for $n \in \mathbb{N}$ , does not belong to S. A probability function on a σ -field S, p:S→ R, satisfies the following axioms: i’. $p(A)\geq0$ , for $A\in S$ ; ii’. $p(Γ)= 1$ ; ∞ A ∩ A = ∅ iii’. p( $n= 1$ ∞ A)= $p(A1)+\dots + p( AN)$ +… = ∑ $p(A)$ , for n n i j n= 1, for i≠ j.

It is evident that axiom (iii΄), commonly called the countable additivity property of the probability function, extends finite additivity to the case of a countably infinite family of events. Originally, Kolmogorov suggested a different axiom, equivalent to countable additivity, the axiom of continuity (1933: 14): iii΄΄. For a monotone sequence of events $\{A_n\}_{n \in \mathbb{N}}$ , with $A_n \supseteq A_{n+1}$ , $n \geq 1$ such that $n= 1$ ∞ A = ∅ n p A ⟶ 0 n→ ∞, ( n) when. In what follows, there are many interpretations of mathematical probabilities that are actually interpretations of elementary probability theory and that face serious problems when applied to mathematical probability theory formulated in σ-fields. A special probability function p(⦁∨ A):S→ R can be defined on S, if one is given a function p on S and a random event $A\in S$ such that $p(A)\neq0$ : p(B∩ A) $p(B\lor A)$ = , for B∈ S p( A) p(⦁∨ A) determines the conditional probability p( $B\lor A$ ) of some event B∈ S given A p(B) Ban event, while is the unconditional probability of . The conditional probability $A\in S$ given an event $B\in S$ of any random event, $p(B\lor A)$ , can be understood a s unconditional probability of an event D, $p (D)$ A, p determined by a probability function A S on a reduced event space A consisting of subsets of the event A∈ S p:S → R that one conditionalizes on; namely, A A, $p (D)= p(B\lor A)$ S = {D:D= B∩ A, for $B\in S$ \., where A A In the tossing of a fair die example, the conditional probability of any outcome, $B= E$ , $i= 1$ ,… 6 A= E event $\{E_i\}$ , given that it is an even number, event $\{E_2, E_4, E_6\}$ , provided by the conditional probability function p(⦁∨ A), defined on the σ-field S. p E = Since the die is fair, ({ i) $i= 1$ ,…,6 p(B∩ A)= for; also, for $B= E$ , $i= 2$ ,4,6 $E$ , while p(B∩ A)= 0 otherwise; using the finite additivity axiom,

$p(A) = p(\{E_2\}) + p(\{E_4\}) + p(\{E_6\}) = \frac{1}{6} + \frac{1}{6} + \frac{1}{6} = \frac{1}{2}$ ; so, $p(B\lor A)$ =, for $B= E$ , $i= 2$ ,4,6, and $p(B\lor A)= 0$ otherwise. Now, consider the reduced event space { i\ S A E p_A consisting of the subsets of $\{E_2, E_4, E_6\}$ . Since the die is fair, $p_A(\{E_i\})$ , for

$p (B)= i= 2$ ,4,6 and, $A = p(B\lor A) B= E$ , $i= 2$ ,4,6 and $p_A(\emptyset) = p(\emptyset | A) = 0$ , while 0 otherwise. Kolmogorov’s axiomatic account, the standard mathematical textbook account of probability theory, explicates the concepts of random event and event space in terms of set theory. Yet, Boole proposed another form under which all questions in the theory of probabilities may be viewed; and this form consists in substituting for events the propositions which assert that those events have occurred, or will occur; and viewing the element of numerical probability as having reference to the truth of those propositions, not to the occurrence of the events concerning which they make assertion. (1853:190) This formulation of probability theory is very common in philosophical contexts, especially when discussing inductive inference. It typically concerns elementary probability theory, presented in the language of sentential logic. Elements of this account can be found in Appendix 6.a, and the reader may also consult (Howson and Urbach 2006: Ch.2). This article presents just a few propositions of elementary probability theory as formulated in this setting that will be useful in what follows:  Probability 1 is assigned to tautologies and probability 0 to contradictions. All other sentences have probability values between 0 and 1.  The probability of the negation of sentence a is 1 − $p(a)$ . a,b  The probability of the disjunction of two inconsistent sentences is the sum of probabilities of the sentences: $p(a\lor b)= p(a)+ p(b)$ . a b  The conditional probability of a sentence given the truth of a sentence is $p(a\land b) p(a\lor b)$ = , p(b)≠0. p(b)  Bayes’s Theorem. The posterior probability of a hypothesis h – that is, the probability of h conditional on evidence e – is $p(h|e) = \frac{p(e|h) \cdot p(h)}{p(e)}$ , where $p(h), p(e) > 0$ $p(e|h)$ where is called the likelihood of the hypothesis and expresses the probability of the evidence conditional on the hypothesis; $p(h)$ is called the prior probability of the hypothesis; and $p(e)$ is the probability of the evidence.

This brief introduction to mathematical probability concludes with the following A,A,A instructive application of Bayes’s theorem. A factory uses three engines to A A produce a product. The first engine, produces 1000 items, the second, 2000 items and the third, A, 3000 items, per day. Of these items, 4%, 2%, and 4%, respectively, are faulty. What is the probability of a faulty product having been h produced by a given engine in a day? Let i be the hypothesis: “A product has been A produced by engine in a day”, for $i= 1$ ,2,3, and e: “A faulty product has been h produced in a day”. Then the prior probabilities of are, p h = (1) ;p h = (2) ; p h = (3) and the likelihoods are p e h = 0.04, p e h = 0.02; (| 1) (| 2) p e h = 0.04 (|), respectively. Using the theorem of total probability (see Appendix 6a), once can calculate $p(e)$ = p h p e h + p h p e h + p h p e h = () (|) () (|) () (|) 1 1 2 2 3 3 ∙0.04+ ∙0.02+ ∙0.04=. By applying Bayes’s theorem one obtains the posterior probability for each hypothesis, p h e = 0.20; p h e = 0.20; p h e = 0.60 (|) (|) (|), that is, the probability of a faulty product to have been produced by a given engine in a day.

b. Interpretations of Probability

As any other part of mathematics, probability theory does not have on its own any empirical meaning and cannot be applied to games of chance, to the study of physical or biological systems, to risk evaluation or insurance policies, and, in general, to empirical science and practical issues, unless one provides an interpretation of its axioms and theorems. This is what Wesley Salmon (1966: 63) dubbed the philosophical problem of probability:

It is the problem of finding one or more interpretations of the probability calculus that yield a concept of probability, or several concepts of probability, which do justice to the important applications of probability in empirical science and in practical affairs. Such interpretations whether one or several would provide an explication of the familiar notion of probability. Salmon suggested three criteria that an interpretation of probability is desirable to satisfy. The first one is called admissibility, and it requires that the probability concepts satisfy the mathematical relations of the calculus of probability, that is, the axioms of Kolmogorov. This is a minimal requirement for the concept of probability to be an interpretation of mathematical probability, but not a trivial one, since countable additivity may be a problem for some interpretations of probability (see 2.a.i and 2.b), while in others, Kolmogorov’s axioms are supposed to follow naturally from the practice of gambling (see 4.a and 4.b). The second criterion is ascertainability. This requires that there should be a method by which, in principle at least, one can ascertain values of probabilities. If it is impossible to find out what the values of probability are, then the concept of probability is useless. Again, not all suggested interpretations satisfy this requirement. According to Salmon, Reichenbach’s frequency interpretation fails to meet this requirement (1966: 89ff.). Finally, applicability is the third criterion: a concept of probability should be applicable, that is, it should have a practical predictive significance. The force of this criterion is manifested in everyday life, in science as well as in the logical structure of science. The concept of scientific confirmation provides a venerable example of application of probability theory. Interpretations of probability theory may be classified under two general families: inductive and physical probability. The classical, the logical, and the subjective interpretations of probability are deemed inductive, while the frequency and the propensity interpretations yield physical probabilities. To illustrate the difference between inductive and physical probability, an example may be instructive (Maher, 2006). Think of a coin that you know is either two-headed or two-tailed, but you have no information about which it is. What is the probability that it would land heads, if tossed? One possible answer would be that the probability is, since there are two possibilities, and there is no evidence which one is going to be realized. Another answer would say that the probability is either 0, if the coin is two-tailed, or 1, if two-headed, but it is not known which. Maher suggests that if ‘ ’ occurs as a natural answer, then one understands ‘probability’ in the sense of inductive probability while the sense in which ‘0 or 1’ occurs as a natural answer is physical probability. What is the difference between the two meanings? Inductive probability is relative to available evidence, and it does not depend on how the unknown part of the world is, that is, on unknown facts of the matter. Thus, if in this example one comes to know that the coin tossed has a head on one side, one should revise the probability estimate in the light of new evidence and claim that now the inductive probability is 1. On the other hand, physical probability is not relative to evidence, and it depends on facts that may be unknown. This is why the further piece of information entertained does not alter the physical probability (it is still ‘0 or 1’).

2. What is Probability?

a. The Classical Interpretation

Pierre Simon Laplace proposed what has come to be known as the classical interpretation of probability in his work The Analytical Theory of Probabilities (1812) and in the much shorter A Philosophical Essay on Probabilities (1814), a book based on a lecture on probabilities he delivered in 1795. His deterministic view of the universe, Laplacian determinism, is well known. Not only did he believe that every aspect of the world, any event that takes place in the universe, is governed by the principle of sufficient reason “the evident principle that a thing cannot occur without a cause which produces it” (1814: 3) but also that “[w]e ought…t o regard the present state of the universe as the effect of its anterior state and as the cause of the one which is to follow” (1814: 4). Moreover, he claimed that the universe is knowable, in principle, and that a supreme intelligence that could comprehend all the forces by which nature is animated and the respective situation of the beings who compose it—a n intelligence sufficiently vast to submit these data to analysis—i t would embrace in the same formula the movements of the greatest bodies of the universe and those of the lightest atom. (ibid) However, human intelligence is weak. It cannot provide an adequate unified picture of the world and subsume the macroscopic and microscopic realm under the province of a single formula. Nor can it give the causes of all events that occur and render them predictable. Thus, ignorance emerges as an expression of human limitation. Laplace stressed that“the curve described by a simple molecule of air or vapor is regulated in a manner just as certain as the planetary orbits; the only difference between them is that which comes from our ignorance” (1814: 6).

Due to ignorance of the true causes, he claimed, people believe in final causation, or they make chance (‘hazard’ in Laplacian terminology) an objective feature of the world. “[B]ut these imaginary causes” explains Laplace, “have gradually receded with the widening bounds of knowledge and disappear entirely before sound philosophy, which sees in them only the expression of our ignorance of the true causes” (1814: 3).

b. Probability as a Measure of Ignorance

In this context, Laplace interpreted probability as a measure of our ignorance, making it dependent on evidence one is aware of or on a lack of such evidence: Probability is relative, in part to this ignorance, in part to our knowledge. We know that of three or a greater number of events a single one ought to occur; but nothing induces us to believe that one of them will occur rather than the others. In this state of indecision, it is impossible for us to announce their occurrence with certainty. It is, however, probable that one of these events, chosen at will, will not occur because we see several cases equally possible which exclude its occurrence, while only a single one favors it. (1814: 6)

The measure of probability of an event is determined by considering equally probable cases that either favor or exclude its occurrence, and the concept of probability is reduced to the notion of equally probable events: The theory of chance consists in reducing all the events of the same kind to a certain number of cases equally possible, that is to say, to such as we may be equally undecided about in regard to their existence, and in determining the number of cases favorable to the event whose probability is sought. The ratio of this number to that of all the cases possible is the measure of this probability, which is thus simply a fraction whose numerator is the number of favorable cases and whose denominator is the number of all the cases possible. (1814: 6- 7)

Laplace claims that the probability of an event is the ratio of the number of favorable cases to that of all possible cases. And this principle of the calculus of probability has for Laplace the status of a definition: “The first of these principles is the definition itself of probability, which, as has been seen, is the ratio of the number of favorable cases to that of all the cases possible” (1814: 11). In the jargon of the mathematical theory of probability, one may consider a partition $A$ of the event space S, that is, a family of mutually exclusive subsets k k= 1 … n A ∩ A = ∅ $k= 1 nA = Γ$ exhaustive of the sample space, and – and assume equal i j k A p A = p A, 1 ≤i, j≤n probability for all random events k, ( i) ( j) for every. Now, for every event E that is decomposable into any sub-family $A \subseteq A$ $E$ $E$ , kl l= 1 … m k k= 1 … n E= $l= 1$ mA, k the probability of E is,

$p(E)$ = numberoffavorablecasesforE = n. numberofpossiblecases.

One can easily show that a function defined in this way satisfies the axioms of elementary probability theory: $p(A)\geq0$ , for $A\in S$ ; $p(Γ)= 1$ ; $p(A\cup B)= p( A)+ p(B)$ , for A∩ B= ∅. Hence, Laplace’s first principle suggests an admissible, in Salmon’s sense, interpretation of the elementary theory. Countable additivity (axiom iii΄), on the other hand, is not satisfied for an event space of countably infinite cardinality. To show this, consider an infinite partition A A p A ≥0 { k\ and assign equal probability to all s, ( k). Then by employing $k= 1$ … ∞ k axioms i΄ and ii΄ along with the equal probability condition and countable additivity (axiom iii΄), one is led to the following absurdity: 1 = $p(Γ)$ = p

Hence, classical interpretation is not an admissible interpretation of the mathematical theory of probability in general. It singles out only certain models of probability theory (elementary theory) in which the cardinality of the event space is finite. Another criticism raised against the classical interpretation (Hajek, 2019) is related to its applicability. The classical interpretation of probability allows only rational-valued probability functions, defined in terms of a ratio of integers. However, in many branches of science, theories (for instance, quantum mechanics) assign to events irrational probability values. In these cases, one cannot interpret probability values in terms of the ratio of the number of favorable cases over the total number of cases. As has already been discussed, in the definition of probability, Laplace presupposes that all cases are equally probable. This fact gives rise to a well-known criticism, namely, that of circularity of the definition of probability: if the relation of equiprobability of two events depends conceptually on what probability is, then the definition of probability is circular. To avoid this criticism, the Soviet mathematician and student of Kolmogorov Boris Gnedenko considered the notion of equal probability a primitive notion “which is… basic and is not subject to a formal definition” (1978: 23). Laplace, in several places, wrote about “equally possible” cases as if ‘possibility’ and ‘probability’ were terms that could be used interchangeably. To assume that is to commit a category mistake, as Hayek has pointed out, since possibilities do not come in degrees. Nevertheless, as shall be seen in section 3.a.1, the connection between possibility and probability can be established in terms of Keynes’s principle of indifference. The same section discusses the paradoxes of indifference that also undermine Laplace’s idea of probability.

b. Probabilities as Frequencies

The frequency interpretation of probability can be traced back to the work of R. L. Ellis and John Venn in the middle of nineteenth century, and it has been described as “a ‘British Empiricist’ reaction to the ‘Continental rationalism’ of Laplace” (Gillies 2000: 88). In Ellis’s article “On the Foundations of the Theory of Probability” (1842), the rudiments of this interpretation are identified: “If the probability of a given event be correctly determined, the event will, on a long run of trials, tend to recur with frequency proportional to this probability.”

Venn presented his own account, a few years later, in 1888, in The Logic of Chance: “[W]e may define the probability or chance… of the event happening in that particular way as the numerical fraction which represents between the two different classes in the long run” (1888: 163).

The real boost, however, for the frequency interpretation was given in the early twentieth century, with the advent of Logical Empiricism, by Richard von Mises in Vienna, and Hans Reichenbach in Berlin. The first, in his work Probability, Statistics and Truth, published in German in 1928, provides a thorough mathematical and operationalist account of probability theory as empirical science, like empirical geometry and the science of mechanics. The account has been presented more rigorously in von Mises’ posthumously published work, entitled Mathematical Theory of Probability and Statistics (1964). Reichenbach presented his mature views on probability in the work The Theory of Probability: an inquiry into the logical and mathematical foundations of the calculus of probability, originally published in Turkey in 1935. In this work, Reichenbach attempted to establish a probability logic, based on the relation of probability implication, which is governed by four axioms. Relative frequencies of sub-series of events in a larger series are interpreted as probabilities, and they are shown to satisfy the axioms of probability logic. However, Reichenbach’s milestone contribution concerns the connection between probability theory and the problem of induction. This section focuses mainly on the frequency interpretation of probability as suggested by von Mises, while for Reichenbach’s views the reader may consult the IEP article on The Problem of Induction (Psillos and Stergiou, 2022). Von Mises claimed that the subject matter of probability theory are repetitive events – “same event that repeats itself again and again” -and mass phenomena – “a great number of uniform elements… [occurring] at the same time” (1928: 11). Probability, according to von Mises, is defined in terms of a collective, a concept which “denotes a sequence of uniform events or processes which differ by certain observable attributes, say colors, numbers or anything else” (1928: 12). For example, take a plant coming from a given seed as a single instance of a collective which consists of a large number of plants coming from the given type of seed. All members of the collective differ from each other with respect to some attribute, say the color of the flower or the height of the plant. In the case of tossing a die, the collective consists of the long series of tosses, and the attribute which distinguishes the instances is the number that appears on the face of the die. The mathematical representation of such finite empirical collectives is given in terms of their idealized counterpart, the infinite ordered sequences of events, which exhibit attributes that are subsets of the attribute space of the collective (which is no different from what has been called sample space). Yet, to be an empirical collective, a sequence of events should satisfy two empirically well-confirmed laws that dictate the mathematical axioms of probability theory in the ideal case of the infinite sequences. The first law, dubbed by Keynes (1921: 336) the Law of Stability of Statistical Frequencies, requires that “the relative frequencies of certain attributes become more and more stable as the number of observations is increased”(von Mises 1928: 12).

Thus, if Ω is the attribute space, $A\subseteq Ω$ is an attribute and $m(Α)$ is the number of manifestations of Α in the first n members of the collective, the relative frequency, $m(Α)$ , tends to a fixed number as the number n of observations increases. According n to von Mises, the Law of Stability of Statistical Frequencies is confirmed by observations in all games of chance (dice, roulette, lotteries, and so forth), in data from insurance companies, in biological statistics, and so on (von Mises 1928: 16-21). This empirical law gives rise to the axiom of convergence for infinite sequences of $m(A)$ A C lim events: for an arbitrary attribute of a collective, n→ ∞ exists. n Τhis law can be traced back to the views of von Mises’s predecessors. For instance, Venn thought that probability is about “a large number or succession of objects, or… series of them” (1888: 5). This series should be “indefinitely numerous,” and it should “combine individual irregularity with aggregate regularity” (1888: 4). All series, for Venn, initially exhibit irregularity, if one considers only their first elements, while, subsequently, a regularity may be attested. This regularity, however, can be unstable, and it can be destroyed in the long run, in the “ultimate stage” of the series. According to Venn, a series is of the fixed type if it preserves the uniformity, while it is of the fluctuating type if “the uniformity is found at last to fluctuate” (1888: 17). Probability is defined only for series of the fixed type; if a series is of the fluctuating type, it is not the subject of science (1888: 163). But what does it mean, in terms of relative frequencies, that a series is of the fixed type? “The one [fixed type] tends without any irregular variation towards a fixed numerical proportion in its uniformity” (ibid). In more detail: “As we keep on taking more terms of the series we shall find the proportion still fluctuating a little, but its fluctuations will grow less. The proportion, in fact, will gradually approach towards some fixed numerical value, what mathematicians term its limit” (1888: 164). The second presupposition for a sequence to be a collective is an original contribution of von Mises. Apart from the existence of limiting relative frequencies in infinite sequences, he demanded the sequence to be random in the sense that there is no rule-governed selection of a subsequence of the original sequence that would yield a different relative frequency of the attribute in question from the one obtained in the original sequence. In von Mises’s own words: [T]hese fixed limits are not affected by place selection. That is to say, if we calculate the relative frequency of some attribute not in the original sequence, but in a partial set, selected according to some fixed rule, then we require that the relative frequency so calculated should tend to the same limit as it does in the original set… The fulfilment of the condition… will be as the Principle of Randomness or the Principle of Impossibility of a Gambling System. (1957: 29)

In a more detailed account of how the subsequence is obtained by place selection, von Mises (1964: 9) explained that, in inspecting all elements of the original sequence, the decision to keep the nth element in or to reject it from the subsequence depends either on the ordinal number n of this element or on the attributes manifested in the (n− 1) preceding elements. This decision does not depend on the attribute exhibited by the nth or by any subsequent element. Von Mises suggested that one should understand the Principle of Impossibility of a Gambling System by analogy to the Principle of Conservation of Energy. As the energy principle is well-confirmed by empirical data about physical systems, so the principle of randomness is well-confirmed for random sequences manifested in games of chance and in data from insurance companies. Moreover, as the principle of conservation of energy prohibits the construction of a perpetual motion machine, the principle of impossibility of a gambling system prohibits the realization of a rule-governed strategy in games of chance that would yield perpetual wealth to the gambler: “We can characterize these two principles, as well as all far-reaching laws of nature, by saying that they are restrictions which we impose on the basis of our previous experience, upon our expectation of the further course of natural events” (1928: 26).

Having defined the concept of a collective that is appropriate for the theory of probability in terms of the two aforementioned laws, one may now define the ‘probability of an attribute A within a given collective C’ in terms of the limiting value of relative frequency of the given attribute in the collective:

p(A) = \lim_{n \to \infty} \frac{m(A)}{n}

Thus defined, probabilities are always conditional to a given collective. Does, however, this definition provide an admissible concept of probability in compliance with Kolmogorov’s axioms? It is straightforward that axioms

(i) and (ii) are satisfied. Namely, since for every $m(A)$ n∈ N,0≤ ≤1, it follows that 0≤ p (A)≤1. And if the attribute examined n consists in the entire attribute space Ω, then it will be satisfied by any member of the $m(Ω)$ sequence, $n = n = 1$ , so, taking limits, $p (Ω)= 1$ . n Regarding the axiom of finite additivity (iii), one sees that, for any pair of mutually exclusive attributes A,B, the number of times that either A or B occurs is the sum of the occurrences of A and B, since the two cannot occur together: $m(A\cup B) m(A\cup B)= m(A)+m(B)\Rightarrow m(A)$ = n m(B) + n. n

By taking limits

$p(A \cup B) = p(A) + p(B)$ .

However, von Mises’s concept of probability does not satisfy the axiom of countable additivity (axiom iii΄). To show that, consider the following infinite Ω attribute space $A = \{A_1, \ldots, A_k\}$ and assume that each attribute appears only 1 k k once in the course of an infinite sequence of repetitions of the experiment, then $p (Α)= 0$ , for every $k\in N$ . If the countable additivity condition were true, then C k p (Ω)= p A +… + p A + $\dots = 0$ . However, this is absurd, since it violates the C C(1) $C( k) p (Ω)= 1$ normalization condition. To provide a probability theory that satisfies all Kolmogorov axioms, von Mises restricted further the scope of a collective. In addition to the Law of Stability of Statistical Frequencies and the Principle of Randomness, in his Mathematical Theory of Probability he required a third, independent condition that a collective should satisfy (von Mises 1964: 12). Namely, that for a denumerable attribute space Ω = Α,…,Α,… { 1 k \

\infty m( A) k \sum n\to \infty k= 1 = 1. n

To define conditional probability, begin with a given collective C and pick out all elements that exhibit some attribute B. Assuming that they form a new collective, B m(A) one can calculate the limiting relative frequency $p ( A)$ = lim CB n→ ∞ in. B n The conditional probability of A given B in the collective C is then

p (A|B)= p (A). B

B C C In case attribute is manifested only a finite number of times in, then B is a set of a finite cardinality; hence, it does not qualify as a collective and conditional probability is not defined. To avoid this ill-defined case, Gillies suggested requiring that $p (B)\neq0$ . Given this condition, he shows all prerequisites for to be a C B collective are satisfied and conditional probability can be defined (Gillies, 2000:112). Von Mises’s account of probability has been criticized as being too narrow with respect to the common use of the term ‘probability’: there are important situations in which one applies the term although one cannot define a collective. Take, for instance, von Mises’s question “Is there a probability of Germany being at some time in the future involved in a war with Liberia” (1928: 9)? Since one does not refer to repetitive or mass events, one cannot define a collective and, in the frequency interpretation, the question is meaningless, since ‘probability’ is meaningfully used only with reference to a collective. Hence, many common uses of ‘probability’ in ordinary language become illegitimate if one thinks in terms of the empirical science of probability as delineated by von Mises. Some may think that this is not an objection at all: von Mises explicates probability in a way that legitimizes only some uses of the term as it occurs in ordinary language and, in this way, he deals with the problem of single-case probabilities that burdens the frequency interpretation: associating probability with (limiting) relative frequency yields trivial certainty (probability equal to 1) for all unrepeated or unrepeatable events. The solution offered by von Mises is to exclude definitionally such events from the domain of application of the concept of probability. Of course, there are alternative ways to understand probability, not as relative frequency, that render its use to unrepeated or unrepeatable events legitimate. Take for instance the subjectivist account (see section 4), which considers probability as a measure of the degree of belief. In this conception, the question acquires meaning requesting the degree of belief an agent would assign to that proposition. In addition, to be on the safe side and avoid paradoxes, one may request coherence from the agent, that is, that their degrees of belief satisfy Kolmogorov’s axioms of probability. A criticism raised against von Mises’s account by de Finetti underlines that the theory fails to deal with the role of probability in induction and confirmation: “If an essential philosophical value is attributed to probability theory, it can only be by assigning to it the task of deepening, explaining or justifying the reasoning by induction. This is not done by von Mises” (De Finetti 1936).

In response to investigations on probability that aim to produce a theory of induction, von Mises claims that probability theory itself is an inductive science and it would be circular to try to justify inductive methodology by means of a science that applies it or to provide any degree of confirmation for any other branch or science:

According to the basic viewpoint of this book, the theory of probability in its application to reality is itself an inductive science; its results and formulas cannot serve to found the inductive process as such, much less to provide numerical values for the plausibility of any other branch of inductive science, say the general theory of relativity. (1928: vii)

However, it is not that the frequency interpretation, in general, does not contribute to the problem of induction. Reichenbach thought that the frequency interpretation of probability theory provides a new context for understanding the problem of induction. (See Problem of Induction.)

c. Are Propensities Probabilities?

The propensity interpretations are a family of accounts of physical probability. They aim to provide an account of objective chance in terms of probability theory. Originally, this interpretation was developed by Karl Popper (1959), but later David Miller, James Fetzer, Donald Gillies and others developed their own accounts (see Gillies 2000). Paul Humphreys (1985) describes propensities as [I]ndeterministic dispositions possessed by systems in a particular environment, exemplified perhaps by such quite different phenomena as a radioactive atom’s propensity to decay and my neighbor’s propensity to shout at his wife on hot summer days.

The problems that guided Popper to abandon the frequency interpretation of probability and to develop this new account had to do, on the one hand, with the interpretation of quantum theory, and on the other, with objective single-case probabilities. To deal with the problem of single-case probabilities, Popper suggested that probabilities should be associated not with sequences of events but with the generating conditions of these sequences, that is, “the set of conditions whose repeated realisation produces the elements of the sequence” (1959). He claimed that “probability may… be said to be a property of the generating conditions” (ibid). This was not just an analysis of the meaning of the term ‘probability’. Popper claimed to have proposed “a new physical hypothesis (or perhaps a metaphysical hypothesis) analogous to the hypothesis of Newtonian forces. It is the hypothesis that every experimental arrangement (and therefore every state of the system) generates physical propensities which can be tested by frequencies” (ibid). The propensity interpretation is supposed to avoid a number of problems faced by the frequency interpretation; for instance, it avoids the problem of inferring probabilities in the limit. But, especially in Popper’s version, it faces the problem of specifying the conditions on the basis of which propensities are calculated – the ascertainability requirement fails. Given that an event can be part of widely different conditions, its propensity will vary according to the conditions. Does it then make sense to talk about the true objective singular probability of an event? Even if this problem is not taken seriously (after all, the advocate of propensities may well claim that propensities are the sort of thing that varies with the conditions), it has been argued on other grounds that probabilities cannot be identified with propensities. Namely, so-called inverse probabilities, although they are mathematically well-defined, remain uninterpreted since it does not make sense to talk about inverse propensities. Suppose, for instance, that a factory produces red socks and blue socks and uses two machines (Red and Blue) one for each color. Suppose also that some socks are faulty and that each machine has a definite probability to produce a faulty sock, say one out of ten socks produced by the Red machine is faulty. One can meaningfully say that the Red machine has a one-tenth propensity to produce faulty socks. But one can also ask the question: given an arbitrary faulty sock, what is the probability that it has been produced by the Red machine? From a mathematical point of view, the question is well-posed and has a definite answer [for a detailed computation of probabilities in a similar example, see section 1a above]. But one cannot make sense of this answer under the propensity interpretation. One cannot meaningfully ask: what is the propensity of an arbitrary faulty sock to have been produced by the Red machine? Propensities, as dispositions, possess the asymmetry of the cause-and-effect relation that cannot be adequately expressed in terms of the symmetric conditional probabilities. Thus, there are well-defined mathematical probabilities that cannot be interpreted as propensities (see Humphreys 1985). Is this really a problem for the propensity interpretation? One would say yes if a probability interpretation aspires to conform with Kolmogorov’s axioms (admissibility requirement) and also claims to provide a complete interpretation of probability calculus. But this condition is not universally accepted. One may suggest that probability interpretations are partial interpretations of the probability calculus or even take the more radical position to abandon the criterion of admissibility, as Humphreys suggested.

3. Probability as the Logic of Induction

a. Keynes and The Logical Concept of Probability

John Maynard Keynes presented his account of probability in the work titled A Treatise on Probability (1921). He attempted to provide a logical foundation for probability based on the concept of partial entailment. In deductive logic, entailment, considered semantically, expresses the validity of an inference, and partial entailment is meant to be its extension to inductive logic. From a semantical point of view, partial entailment expresses a probability relation between the conclusion of an inference and its premises, that is, that the conclusion is rendered likely true (or more likely to be true) given the truth of the premises. Here is how Keynes (1921: 52) understood this extension and its relation to probability: Inasmuch as it is always assumed that we can sometimes judge directly that a conclusion follows from a premiss, it is no great extension of this assumption to suppose that we can sometimes recognise that a conclusion partially follows from, or stands in a relation of probability to a premiss. And

We are claiming, in fact, to cognise correctly a logical connection between one set of propositions which we call our evidence and which we suppose ourselves to know, and another set which we call our conclusions, and to which we attach more or less weight according to the grounds supplied by the first…. It is not straining the use of words to speak of this as the relation of probability. (Keynes 1921: 5–6)

Thus, partial entailment rests on an analogy with deductive (full) entailment, and both concepts express logical relations, the former of deductive and the latter of inductive logic. Here is an example: the conjunction (p and q) entails deductively p; by analogy, it is said that, though proposition p does not (deductively) entail the conjunction (p and q), it entails it partially, since it entails one of its conjuncts (for instance, p). The difference between the two kinds of entailment stems from the fact that the validity of an inference, expressed in deductive entailment, is a yes-or-no question, while the probability relation, expressed in partial entailment, comes in degrees. Keynes (1921: 4) considered probability to be the degree of rational belief that a future occurrence of an event under specified circumstances is partially entailed from past evidence for the occurrence of similar events under similar circumstances: “Let our premises consist of any set of propositions h, and our conclusion consist of any set of propositions a, then, if a knowledge of hjustifies a rational belief in a of degree α, we say that there is a probability-relation of degree α between a andh.” To say that the probability of a conclusion is high or low given a set of premises is not for Keynes a matter of subjective evaluation of the believer. It shares the objectivity of any other logical relation between propositions. That is why Keynes (1921: 4) talks about the degree of rational belief and not simply of a degree of belief: [I]n the sense important to logic, probability is not subjective. It is not, that is to say, subject to human caprice. A proposition is not probable because we think it so. When once the facts are given which determine our knowledge, what is probable or improbable in these circumstances has been fixed objectively, and is independent of our opinion. The Theory of Probability is logical, therefore, because it is concerned with the degree of belief which it is rational to entertain in given conditions, and not merely with the actual beliefs of particular individuals, which may or may not be rational.

It should be noted that Keynes based his defense of the logical character of the probability relations on what he called “logical intuition,” namely, a certain capacity possessed by agents in virtue of which they can simply “see” the logical relation between the evidence and the hypothesis. It is in virtue of this shared intuition that different agents can have the same rational degree of belief in a certain hypothesis in light of certain evidence. This view was immediately challenged by Frank Ramsey, who, referring to Keynes’s “logical relations” between statements, noted, “I do not perceive them and if I am to be persuaded that they exist it must be by argument” (1926, 63). It should be clear that for Keynes probability is not always quantitative. He believed that qualitative probabilities are meaningful as well and that the totality of probabilities, or of degrees of rational belief, may include both numbers and non-numerical elements. In the usual numerical probabilities, all probabilities lie within the unit interval, and they are all comparable in terms of the relation ‘being greater than or equal to’ as defined in real numbers. This relation induces a complete ordering to the unit interval which acquires the structure of a completely ordered set. Since for Keynes probabilities may not be numerical, a different interpretation of the relation “being more probable than or equally probable to,” expressing the comparability of probabilities, is required. In the class of probabilities, Keynes defines a relation of ‘between’ as follows:

AisbetweenB∧ C,(A,B,C)

where, for any three probabilities A,B,C, the relation, if satisfied, is satisfied by a unique ordered triple( A,B,C). He identifies two distinguished probabilities, impossibility, O, and certainty,I, between which all other probabilities lie. Finally, he used the relation of betweenness to compare probabilities:

If AisbetweenO∧ B, the probability B is said to be greater than the probability A.

To illustrate these relations among probabilities, Keynes suggested the following diagram. In this diagram, all probabilities comparable in terms of the ‘greater than’ relation are connected with a continuous path: In Keynes’s (1921: 39) words:

O represents impossibility,I certainty, and A a numerically measurable probability intermediate between O and I; U,V,W,X,Y,Z are nonnumerical probabilities, of which, however, V is less than the numerical probabilityA, and is also less than W,X, and Y. X, and Y are both greater than W, and greater than V, but are not comparable with one another, or with A. V and Z are both less than W,X, and Y, but are not comparable with one another; U is not quantitatively comparable with any of the probabilities V,W,X,Y,Z. Probabilities which are numerically comparable will all belong to one series, and the path of this series, which we may call the numerical path or strand, OAI will be represented by.

b. The Principle of Indifference

To have numerical probabilities between alternative cases, Keynes (1921: 41) believed that equiprobability of the alternatives is required:

“In order that numerical measurement may be possible, we must be given a number of equally probable alternatives,” and “it has always been agreed that a numerical measure can actually be obtained in those cases only in which a reduction to a set of exclusive and exhaustive equiprobable alternatives is practicable” (1921: 65).

In the terminology of the mathematical theory of probability, Keynes stipulates that a real number $p(E\lor H)$ denotes the numerical probability of an event Egiven the truth of some hypotheses H, assigned by a function p satisfying Kolmogorov’s axioms, only if $p(E\lor H)$ can be deduced by or it can be reduced to some initial numerical probabilities $p( A \lor H)$ assigned to the members of a partition {A \ of k k k= 1 … n the event space S that satisfy the equiprobability condition:

p(A \lor H)= p(A \lor H),k,j= 1,\dots,n. k j

What is the basis of equiprobability and how can it be justified? Keynes (1921: 45) suggested that the justification of equiprobability follows from the Principle of Indifference, which states that: [I]f there is no known reason for predicating of our subject one rather than another of several alternatives, then relatively to such knowledge the assertions of each of these alternatives have an equal probability. Thus, equal probabilities must be assigned to each of several arguments, if there is an absence of positive ground for assigning unequal ones. The term ‘Principle of Indifference’ was coined by Keynes in the Treatise on Probability. According to Ian Hacking (1971), this principle can be traced back to Leibniz’s paper “De incerti aestimatione” (1678). In this, Leibniz, anticipating Laplace, claimed that “probability is the degree of possibility. Hope is the probability of having. Fear is the probability of losing.” Leibniz considered that claim as an axiom—s omething very similar to the Principle of Indifference: “If players do similar things in such a way that no distinction can be drawn between them, with the sole exception of the outcome, there is the same proportion of hope to fear.”

Moreover, he suggested understanding this axiom as having its source in metaphysics, which seems to be an allusion to the Principle of Sufficient Reason and, in particular, to the claim that God does, or creates, nothing without a sufficient reason. Applying this metaphysical principle to the expectations of rational agents, that is, ‘players’, one gets the following axiom, as Hacking suggested (1975:126): “If several players engage in the same contest in such a way that no difference can be ascribed to them (except insofar as they win or lose) then each player has exactly the same ground for ‘fear or hope’.”

Keynes, however, traces the principle of indifference to Jacques (James) Bernoulli’s Principle of Non-Sufficient Reason (1921: 41). Bernoulli, in his Ars Conjectandi, attempted to calculate the “degree of certainty, or probability, that the argument generates” (notice that by ‘argument’ he meant a piece of evidence), and he assumed that “all cases are equally possible, or can happen with equal ease.” There are examples, however, in which a case happens more ‘easily’ than others. Then, according to Bernoulli (1713: 219), one needs to make a correction: “For any case that happens more easily than the others as many more cases must be counted as it more easily happens. For example, in place of a case three times as easy I count three cases each of which may happen as easily as the rest.” Thus, Bernoulli suggested that, to save equiprobability, one should consider a finer partition of the sample space by subdividing the ill-behaved case into distinct cases. Keynes was aware that the principle faces a number of difficulties which take the form of a paradox: it predicted contradictory evaluations of probabilities in specific cases. To resolve these paradoxes and avoid ill cases, he attempted to provide restrictions to the application of the principle of indifference. The first paradox is known as the Book Paradox. Consider a book of unknown cover color. There is no reason to believe that its color is red rather than not red. Hence, by the principle of indifference, the probability of being red is. In a similar

vein, the probability of being green, yellow, or blue are all, which contradicts the theorem of probability that the sum of probabilities of mutually exclusive events is less than or equal to. The second paradox is the Specific Volume Paradox. Consider the specific volume v of a given liquid and assume that 1 ≤v≤3 in some system of units. Given that there is no reason to assume that 1 ≤v≤2, rather than 2≤v≤3, by the principle of indifference it is equally likely for the specific volume to lie in each one of these d= intervals. Next, consider the specific density. Given the original assumption,

one is justified to infer that ≤d≤1. Similarly, the principle of indifference maintains

that it is equally likely for the specific density to have a value ≤d≤ or to have a value ≤d≤1. Turning now to considerations about specific volume, one finds that it

1 ≤v≤ is equally likely that or ≤v≤3. But it has already been shown that it is as likely for v to lie between 1 and 2 as between 2 and 3. The third paradox that seems to challenge the principle of indifference is Bertrand’s paradox. Bertrand, in his Calcul des Probabilités (1888), argues that the principle of indifference can be applied in more than one way in cases with infinitely many possibilities, giving rise to contradictory outcomes regarding the evaluation of probabilities. In support of his argument he presented, among other examples, his famous paradox: Trace at random a chord in a circle. What is the probability that it would be longer than the side of the inscribed equilateral triangle? Here are some different ways to apply the principle of indifference to solve the problem, each leading to different probability values. The first solution assumes that one end of the requested chord is at a vertex of the triangle and the other lies on the circumference. The circumference is divided in three equal arcs by the vertices of the triangle. From all possible chords traced from the given vertex, only those that lie in the arc which subtends the angle at that vertex are longer than the side of the equilateral triangle. Therefore, the probability is. For the second solution, assume that the chord is parallel to a side of the triangle. From these parallel chords only the ones with a distance less than one-half of the circle’s radius will have a length greater than the side of the inscribed equilateral triangle. Thus, the requested probability is. Finally, one yields a third solution by assuming that the chord is defined by its midpoint. Then a chord is longer than the side of triangle if its midpoint falls within a concentric circle of a radius one-half of the outer circle. The probability is calculated as the ratio of the areas of the two circles and is found to be. Notice that Bertrand’s Paradox can undermine the principle of indifference if and only if the problem at hand is a determinate problem with no unique solution. But there is no agreement on that. Many believe that the problem is ambiguous or underspecified and, in this sense, indeterminate. They claim that once one selects the set of chords from which one draws one at random, the problem has a unique solution by applying the principle of indifference. (For an interesting discussion, see Shackel, 2007.) To address the Book and the Specific Volume Paradoxes, Keynes suggested placing a restriction to the application of the Principle of Indifference. One should require that, given one’s state of knowledge, the partition of the sample space, that is, the number of alternative cases, is finite, and each alternative cannot be split up further into a pair of mutually exclusive sub-alternatives which have non-zero probability to occur (see 1921: 60). Now it is obvious that the class of books with a non-red cover can be further subdivided into the class of books with a blue cover and those with a non-blue cover and so on; thus, the adequacy condition for the application of the principle is not satisfied. Similarly, in the case of the ranges of values of the specific volume and the specific density, the principle does not apply, since there is no range of values which does not contain within itself two similar ranges. Finally, for Bertrand’s paradox, since areas, arcs, and segments can be subdivided further into non-overlapping parts without a limit, the principle of indifference is not applicable (see 1921: 62). Yet, for the geometric example, Keynes suggested a solution. Instead of considering as an alternative a point in a continuous line, divide that line into a finite number of m segments, no matter how small, and take as an alternative the segment in which the point under consideration lies. Then apply the principle of indifference to the m alternatives which were considered indivisible. However, Keynes’s solution is not at all clear. Number m can be as great as one desires on the condition that it is kept finite. Hence, who decides what is the number of alternatives to which the principle of indifference is applied? If, on the other hand, is allowed to increase indefinitely, then one gets the continuous case one sought to avoid (see Childers 2013: 126).

c. Keynes on the Problem of Induction

For Keynes, probability is the part of logic that deals with rational but inconclusive arguments; and since inductive reasoning is both inconclusive but rational, induction becomes inductive logic. The key question, of course, is on what grounds are claims that induction is rational justified. According to Keynes, though Hume’s skeptical claims are usually associated with causation, the real object of his attack is induction, that is, the inference from past particulars to future generalizations (see 1921: 312). Keynes’s argument is the following:

(1) A constant conjunction between two events has been observed in the past. This is a fact. Hume does not challenge this at all. (2) What Hume challenges is whether one is justified to infer from a past constant conjunction between two events that it will also hold in the future. (3) This kind of inference is called inductive. (4) So, Hume is concerned with the problem of induction.

To see Keynes’s reaction to the problem of induction, let us first clarify what is for him an inductive argument (1921: 251): “It will be useful to call arguments inductive which depend in any way on the methods of Analogy and Pure Induction.”

Arguments from analogy are based on similarities among the objects of a collection, on their likeness, while Pure Induction is induction by enumeration. As Keynes (ibid) put it, “[w]e argue from… Pure Induction when we trust the number of the experiments.”

Keynes criticized Hume for not taking into account the analogical dimension of an inductive argument by considering the observed instances, which serve as premises, as absolutely uniform (see 1921: 252). Instead, Keynes suggested that the basis of Pure Induction is the likeness of instances in certain respects (positive analogies) and their dissimilarity in others (negative analogies). Only after having verified such a likeness can one single out some features and predict the occurrence of other features or infer a generalization of the sort “all A is B.” Hence (1921: 253):

In an inductive argument, therefore, we start with a number of instances similar in some respects AB, dissimilar in others C. We pick out one or more respects A in which the instances are similar, and argue that some of the other respects Bin which they are also similar are likely to be associated with the characteristics A in other unexamined cases. So, assume that a finite number, n, of instances exhibits a certain group of qualities, a,…,a, and single out two subgroups: 1 r

a,a,a a,a and 1 2 3 r− 1 r

An inductive argument, for Keynes, would conclude that in every instance of a,a,a a,a a,a, qualities are also exhibited, or that qualities are “bound up” with r− 1 r r− 1 r a,a,a qualities 1 2 3 (1921: 290). This account of induction presupposes, claims Keynes (ibid), that qualities in objects are exhibited in groups and “a sub-class of each group [is] an infallible symptom of the coexistence of certain other members of it also.” However, the world may not cooperate to the success of an inductive argument. Keynes identifies three “open possibilities” that would compromise inductive generalization: a a (1) Some quality r− 1 or r may be independent of all other qualities of the instances, that is, there are no groups of qualities that contain the said quality and at least some of the others. a,a,a a,a (2) There are no groups to which both and belong. 1 2 3 r− 1 $r (3)$ a,a,a belong to groups that include a,a and to other groups that do 1 2 3 r− 1 r not include them. a,a,a a,a In any of the three cases, “All are ” fails. Hence, induction fails. 1 2 3 r− 1 r Keynes (1921: 291) suggested an assumption of probabilistic nature that would save us from such ‘pathological’ cases and would lead to a successful induction, namely “[i]f we find two sets of qualities in coexistence there is a finite probability that they belong to the same group, and a finite probability also that the first set specifies this group uniquely.”

If this assumption is granted, then inductive methodology aims to increase the prior probability and make it large, in the light of new evidence. This topic is further discussed later in this section. Keynes discusses the justificatory ground of this assumption and shows that it requires an a priori commitment to the claim that qualitative variety in nature is limited. Although the individuals do differ qualitatively, “their characteristics, however numerous, cohere together in groups of invariable connection, which are finite in number” (1921: 285). This idea is incorporated in the Principle of Limited Variety of a finite system (PLV), which Keynes (1921: 286) stated thus:

[T]he amount of variety in the universe is limited in such a way that there is no one object so complex that its qualities fall into an infinite number of independent groups (i.e. groups which might exist independently as well as in conjunction); or rather that none of the objects about which we generalise are as complex as this; or at least that, though some objects may be infinitely complex, we sometimes have a finite probability that an object about which we seek to generalise is not infinitely complex.

The gist behind the role of PLV is this. Suppose that, although a group of properties, say A, has been invariably associated with a group of properties, B, in the past, there B,…,B is an unlimited variety of groups of properties, 1 n, such that it is logically possible that future occurrences of A will be accompanied by any of the B’s, instead of B. Then, and if one lets n (the variety index) tend to infinity, one cannot even start to say how likely it is that B will occur given A, and the past association of As with B s. PLV excludes the possibility just envisaged. But, as PLV stipulates, there are no infinitely complex objects; alternatively, the qualities of an object cannot fall into an infinite number of independent groups. For Keynes, the qualities of an object are determined by a finite number of primitive qualities; the latter (and their possible combinations) can generate all apparent qualities of an object. Since the number of primitive qualities is finite, the number of groups they generate alone or by being combined is finite. Hence, for any two sets of apparent properties, Keynes (1921: 292) concludes, there is, “in the absence of evidence to the contrary, a finite probability that the second set will belong to the group specified by the first set.” In any case, Keynes takes it that a generalization of the form ‘All As are Bs’ should be read as ‘It is probable that any given A is B’ rather than ‘It is probable that all As are Bs’. So, the issue is the next instance of the observed regularity and not whether it holds generally (1921: 287-288). The absolute assertion of the finiteness of a system under consideration as expressed by the Principle of Limited Variety is called the Inductive Hypothesis (IH) (1921: 299), and it provides one of the premises of an inductive argument; namely, that the a priori probability of the conclusion, $p(C\lor IH)$ , has a finite value. Keynes distinguished (IH) from Inductive Method (IM), which amounts to the process of $p(C\lor IH)$ increasing the a priori probability of the conclusion, by taking into e account the evidence:

$p(C\lor e\land IH)> p(C\lor IH)$ .

(For the mathematics of Keynes’s account of inductive method and the emergence of the need for the inductive hypothesis in order that new evidence strengthen belief in the truth of the conclusion of an inductive argument, the reader may consult Appendix 6.c.) Significantly, Keynes adds that the Inductive Method may be used to strengthen ℑ the Inductive Hypothesis itself. Since IH is a hypothesis, and since is indifferent to the content/status of the hypothesis it applies to, it can be applied to IH itself. In other ℑ words, brings some evidence to bear on the truth of IH. What Keynes suggests is this:

p(IH\lor e'\land IH ')> p(IH\lor IH')

IH ‘ where is another general hypothesis, “more primitive and less far-reaching” than IH, such that p(IH∨ IH ‘) has a finite value, and e’ is other evidence. The argument is non-circular, since the justification of the inductive hypothesis is not accomplished by the hypothesis itself but in terms of some other hypothesis more fundamental, by means of inductive method. Of course, the account runs the risk of exchanging circularity for infinite regress unless there exists some primitive inductive hypothesis. But what would such a primitive inductive hypothesis be? One is left in the dark: “We need not lay aside the belief that this conviction gets its invincible certainty from some valid principle darkly present to our minds, even though it still eludes the peering eyes of philosophy” (1921: 304). However, at the end of the day, Keynes simply argues that a non-zero (finite) a priori probability is assigned to the inductive hypothesis IH (which is equivalent to PLV). What would be the reason to assign an a priori non-zero probability to the inductive hypothesis IH? Keynes answer shows the limitations of all attempts to satisfy the inductive sceptic: “It is because there has been so much repetition and uniformity in our experience that we place great confidence in it” (1921: 289-290). It seems one cannot do better than relying on past experience. The Inductive Hypothesis that supports induction, PLV in Keynes’s case, is neither a self-evident logical axiom nor an object of direct acquaintance (1921: 304). But nevertheless, he insists that it is true of some factual systems. How do we know this? By past experience.

d. On the Rule of Succession

Before leaving Keynes, consider his critique of Laplace’s Rule of Succession, that is, the theorem of mathematical probability which claims that if an event has occurred m $m+1$ times in succession, then the probability that it will occur again is $m+2$ . As discussed in The Problem of Induction, Venn had reasons not to “ take such a rule as this seriously” (1888: 197), but Keynes’s criticism goes well beyond these reasons. The crux of Keynes’s criticism consists in that the derivation of the rule of succession combines two different methods for the determination of the probability of an event which yield different probability values. Thus, their combination is inconsistent, and it includes a latent contradiction. Consider several possible events $E_1, E_2, \ldots, E_n$ that are alternatives, that is, they are 1 2 n mutually exclusive and exhaustive of the sample space, and choose any one of them, E. The first method stipulates that “when we do not know anything about an alternative, we must consider all the possible values of the probability of the alternative; these possible values can form in their turn a set of alternatives, and so on. But this method by itself can lead to no final conclusion” (1921: 426). Let the $p(E)$ probability of the alternative be i. The method stipulates that one should consider E all probability values of assigned by any admissible probability functions p. These E p E,…,p E, probability values for form another set of alternatives, say, () () … i 1 i n i And the same process may be repeated, again and again, leading to an infinite regress. Thus, the first method is inconclusive. The second method applies the principle of indifference, stipulating that “when we know nothing about a set of alternatives, we suppose the probabilities of each of them p E,= … = p E to be equal” (ibid). Thus, the second method concludes that () (). 1 n E E Consider the event, “the sun will rise tomorrow,” and its alternative, “the sun will not rise tomorrow.” If one apples the first method only, one reaches no conclusion about probability, and one is involved in an infinite regress. Secondly, if p E = p E = one apples the second method only, one obtains (1) (2). Finally, in deriving the rule of succession, both methods are applied subsequently. Namely, the probability of E is unknown, and any probability value is possible according to the E first method. Thus, one forms a set of alternatives for the probability of which, at a second stage, is reduced to the equal probability case by applying the second method. This reasoning is presupposed by the rule of succession. The latent contradiction included in the rule of succession is that, for its derivation, it is assumed that the a priori probability of the event can be any number in the interval [0,1 ], with all numbers being equally probable, while by application of the a Npriori probability rule, calculated in the absence of any observations, (=0) is. In Keynes’s (1921: 430) own words:

The principle’s conclusion is inconsistent with its premises. Begin with the assumption that the a priori probability of an event, about which there is no information and no experience, is unknown, and that all values between 0 and 1 are equally probable. This ends with the conclusion that the a priori probability of such an event is … this contradiction was latent, as soon as the Principle of Indifference was superimposed on the principle of unknown probabilities.

4. Carnap’s Inductive Logic

a. Two Concepts of Probability

Carnap presented his views of probability and induction mainly in the two books entitled the Logical Foundations of Probability (1950) and The Continuum of Inductive Methods (1952) and in his papers “A basic system of inductive logic, I, II” (1971 and 1980, respectively) and “Replies and Systematic Expositions” (1963). For Carnap, the theory and principles of inductive reasoning, inductive logic, are the same as probability logic (1950, v), and the primary task to be set toward an account of inductive logic is the explication of probability. Explication, according to Carnap (1950: 3), is the transformation of an inexact, possibly prescientific concept, the explicandum, into a new exact concept, the explicatum, that obeys explicitly stated rules for its use. By means of this transformation, a concept of ordinary discourse or a metaphysical concept may be incorporated into a well-structured body of logico-mathematical or empirical concepts. Explication has a long history as a philosophical method that, in a wide sense, may be traced back even to Plato’s investigations on definitions. Strictly speaking, however, Carnap borrowed the term “Explikation” from Kant and Husserl, while Frege may be considered his precursor in this method of philosophical analysis, and Goodman, Quine, and Strawson among his prominent intellectual inheritors. For a general presentation of the notion explication, consult the IEP article on Explication, (Cordes and Siegwart 2019). Two concepts are distinguished as explicanda of probability according to Carnap: logical or inductive probability, called ‘probability ’ and statistical probability, called ‘probability ’. Both concepts are important for science, and a lack of recognition of this fact, Carnap claimed, has fueled many futile controversies among philosophers. The meaning of probability2 is that of relative frequency of a kind of event in a long sequence of events, and in science it is applied to the description and statistical analysis of mass phenomena. All sentences about statistical probability are factual, empirical. The logical concept of probability, probability1, is the basis for all inductive reasoning. For Carnap (1950: 2), the problem of induction is the problem of the logical relation between a hypothesis and some confirming evidence for it, and “inductive logic is the theory based upon what might be called the degree of inducibility, that is, the degree of confirmation.” Hence, by taking probability to mean “the degree of confirmation of a hypothesis hwith respect to an evidence statement e, e.g., an observational report” (1950: 19), Carnap made it the basis of inductive logic. As for any logical sentence, the truth or falsity of sentences about probability1 is independent of extralinguistic facts. In addition, logical probability is an objective concept, that is, “if a certain probability1 value holds for a certain hypothesis with respect to a certain evidence, then this value is entirely independent of what any person may happen to think about these sentences, just as the relation of logical consequence is independent in this respect” (1950: 43). The objectivity of probability Carnap recognized in the views of Keynes and Jeffreys, who interpreted probability in terms of rational degrees of beliefs as distinguished from subjective, actual degrees of belief a person might bear on the truth of a sentence given some evidence. Later, he (1963: 967) came to accept the interpretation of probability as “the degree to which [one]… i s rationally entitled to believe in h on the basis of e.”

b. C-functions

Carnap suggested three different concepts of confirmation. The classificatory concept of confirmation, which expresses a logical relation between a piece of evidence e and a hypothesis h and, if satisfied, qualifies the former as a confirming instance of the latter. To signify the explicatum of this concept, Carnap used the symbol ‘C’, and C(h,e) corresponds to “h is confirmed or supported by e.” The second concept of confirmation he employed is the comparative concept, which compares the strength e h by which a piece of evidence confirms a hypothesis with the corresponding strength by which e confirms h. Thus, comparative confirmation requires the underlying classificatory confirmation, and it is, in general, a tetradic relation. Its MC h,e,h,e explicatum is symbolized by ‘MC’, where () corresponds to the 1 1 2 2 h e statement ‘’ is confirmed by at least as strongly (that is, either more or equally strongly) as h by e.” Finally, there is a quantitative (or, metrical) concept of confirmation, the degree of confirmation, which assigns a numerical value to the h e degree to which a hypothesis is supported by a given observational evidence. The explicatum of this concept is symbolized by ‘c’, where ‘the degree of ‘c(h,e)= r’ is the statement “the degree of confirmation of h with respect to e isr,” where h and e r are sentences and a real number in the unit interval. In this context, Carnap points out that Keynes’s objective conception of probability is similar to the comparative concept of confirmation and only in some special cases, when the principle of indifference is applicable, can be interpreted quantitatively, similar to his concept of degree of confirmation (1950: 45 & 205). Moreover, notice that all three conceptions of confirmation Carnap (1950: 19) suggested are semantical: “The concepts of confirmation to be dealt with in this book are semantical, i.e., based upon meaning, and logical, i.e., independent of facts.” The inductive relation that the three concepts of confirmation attempt to explicate is not determined by the form of the sentences, as Hempel required in his syntactic account of confirmation (1945), nor depends on the users of a language, as Goodman suggested in his pragmatic solution of the new riddle of induction (1955). Rather, “once h and e are given, the question mentioned requires only that we be able to understand them, that is, to grasp their meanings, and to establish certain relations which are based upon their meanings” (1950: 20). Carnap begins with the construction of the language(s) in which inductive logic is to be applied. He defines several language systems, each one characterized by the number of names (constants) it contains (1950: 58). Each name refers to individuals in the corresponding universe of discourse, be they things, events, or the like. Thus, he considered an infinite language system, having an infinite number of names and a ∞ L,L,…,L,… sequence 1 2 N of language systems, each one characterized by the index N that runs through all positive integers indicating the number of names the system L a L a a includes. Hence, contains only ‘ ‘; contains ‘ ‘ and ‘ ‘; and so forth. Notice 1 1 2 1 2 that any sentence of is contained in an infinite number of finite language systems ∞ of the hierarchy, since if ‘a ’ is the name with highest subscript that appears in that N sentence, then this sentence will be represented in any language system with n≥ N. n Apart from names, L contains a finite number of primitive (atomic) predicates of any ∞ degree (unary, binary, and so forth) designating properties and relations among individuals in the universe of discourse. Carnap considered only three connectives as primitive for his language systems—f the negation ‘ ’, the conjunction ‘’ and the inclusive disjunction ‘∨ ’—a nd he defined implication and the biconditional in terms of these three. Each language system contains an infinite number of variables, x,y,z,x,x …, and two quantifiers, the existential ‘(∃x)’ and the universal Pa ∧ Pa … ∧ Pa ‘(x)’. The sentence ‘(x) Px’ is taken to be logically equivalent to ‘ ’ 1 2 N in a language L, according to the semantics adopted. The same is not true for the N case of, since in this case the conjunction of an infinite number of sentences is not ∞ a well-formed formula of the language. Apart from the atomic predicates, molecular predicates may be defined. They are formed by atomic or more basic molecular P,P,P predicates with the help of connectives. For example, if are atomic P P ∧ P P ∨ P predicates, then ‘ ’ or ‘ ’ or ‘ ’ are molecular predicates understood as 1 1 2 1 3 follows: for any variable x, ( P)x stands for ‘(P1 x)’; ( $P \land P$ )x for ‘ $P (x)\land P (x)$ ’; and ( $P \lor P$ )x for ‘ $P (x)\lor P ( x)$ ’. Finally, language systems 1 2 1 3 1 3 contain an equality symbol ‘’, designating identity of individuals in the universe of discourse, and a tautological sentence ‘t’. As any language, these language systems are equipped with some rules for the formation of well-formed formulas (sentences) and some rules of truth, that is, a semantics. A state description V is an explication of the vague concept of a state of affairs relativized to a given language system L (1950: 70ff.). It purports to describe possible states of the universe of discourse of L. A state description describes for every individual designated by some name ‘a’ and for every property designated by an atomic predicate ‘P’ of L whether or not this individual has that property, and similarly for relations. Thus, a state description will contain exactly one sentence from Pa Pa Pa Pa the pair ‘ ’, ‘ ’: either ‘ ’ or ‘ ’ but not both, and no other element (similarly for relations). In the case of a finite language system, a state description N has the form of a conjunction of sentences of the aforementioned sort, while in the case of an infinite language system, a state description is a class of sentences that ∞ contains at most one sentence of the aforementioned sort. In both cases nothing more is included in a state description. The class of all state descriptions in a given system L is designated by ‘V ’, while the null class is designated by ‘Λ ’. For example, consider a language system with names, ‘a’, ‘b’ and ‘c’ and a single atomic unary predicate symbol ‘P’. The complete set of state descriptions is the following: V1 ‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V5 ‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V2‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V6‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V3 ‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V7 ‘ $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ’ V4 $Pa\land Pb$ ∧ Pc V8 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ ‘ ’ ‘ ’

The adequacy of a language system L for inductive logic requires compliance with two important conditions: the requirement of logical independence and the requirement of completeness. The first condition aims at restricting the language system to bar contradictory state descriptions. The requirement of logical independence stipulates

(i) that atomic sentences (that is, sentences that consist of an n-place predicate and n names) are logically independent, that is, a class containing atomic sentences (for example, sentences of the form Pa for a predicate ‘P’ and a name ‘a’) and the negations of other atomic sentences do not logically entail another atomic sentence or its negation; (ii) that names in L designate different and separate individuals; and (iii) that atomic predicates are interpreted to designate logically independent attributes. The requirement of completeness of language stipulates that the set of the atomic predicates of L be sufficient for expressing every qualitative attribute of the individuals in the universe of discourse of L. This requirement seemed absolutely necessary for the Carnapian system, since the language systems affect the c-values in the theory of inductive logic. For the time being, all that needs to be stressed is that this requirement implies that a language system Lmirrors its universe of discourse. Whatever there is in it can be exhaustively expressed within L. Here is Carnap’s P P example (1950: 75): Take a language system L with only two predicates, ‘ ’ and ‘ ’ interpreted as Bright and Hot. Then, every individual in the universe of discourse of L should differ only with respect to these two attributes. If a new predicate ‘P ’, interpreted as Hard, were added, the -values of hypotheses concerning individuals in would change. Even if this simple scheme holds (or might hold) in a simple language, can it be adequate for the language of natural sciences? A similar requirement had been proposed by Keynes, in the form of the Principle of Limited Variety (see section 3c). Later on, Carnap abandoned this requirement and replaced it with the following: The value of the confirmation function c(h,e) remains unchanged if further families of predicates are added to the language (see 1963: 975). According to this c(h,e) requirement, the value of depends only on the predicates occurring in h and e. Hence, the addition of new predicates to the language does not affect the value of c(h,e). This new idea amounts to what Lakatos (1968: 325) called the minimal language requirement, according to which the degree of confirmation of a proposition depends only on the minimal language in which the proposition can be expressed. Another important concept defined by Carnap is that of the range of a sentence or of a collection of sentences (1950: 78). The range of a sentence i, $R(i)$ is the class of those state descriptions in which that sentence holds. A (molecular) sentence of the form ‘Pa or Pa’ for an atomic predicate ‘P’ and some name ‘a’ holds in a state description V if it is either a conjunct in V’s defining conjunction or it belongs to the class of sentences that define. Analogously, if a sentence is a conjunction of simpler sentences, then all components of the conjunction should hold for a state description, while if it is a disjunction, at least one disjunct should hold in a state description – so that the state description partakes of the sentence’s range. Notice that a tautology holds in all state descriptions. For instance, in the previous example, the range of $Pa\land Pb$ is $R(Pa\land Pb)$ = {V1,V 4,\, while the range of $Pa\lor Pb$ is $R(Pa\lor Pb)$ = {V1,V2,V3,V4,V6,V7\. Finally, the range of a class of sentences is the class of state descriptions in which every sentence of the class holds. The final step before defining the c-function is to present Carnap’s account of logical concepts in a system in terms of state descriptions and the concept of range: a sentence i is L-true in L if and only if $R(i)$ is, while it is L-false in L if and only if $R(i)$ is Λ; a sentence i L-implies j in L if and only if $R(i)$ ⊂ $R( j)$ ; i is L-j, j,…, j equivalent to j in L if and only if $R(i)= R( j)$ ; (n≥2) are L-disjunct with 1 2 n R j ∪ $R( j)\cup \dots \cup R( j)$ V one another in L if and only if () is; i is L-exclusive of j 1 2 n V Λ in L if and only if $R(i)$ ∩ R(j) is; a class of sentences is L-exclusive in pairs if and only if every pair of the class is L-exclusive of every other sentence of that class. L-truth is the explicatum for logical truth or analytical truth, while L-false is the explicatum for contradiction. L-implication is the explicatum for logical entailment, while L-equivalence explicates mutual deducibility, and it is the same as mutual L-implication. L-disjunctness applied to a set of sentences explicates the idea that at least one of those sentences is true, and L-exclusion explicates logical incompatibility or logical impossibility of joint truth. For the sake of simplicity, this article focuses on finite language systems. Thus, m is a regular measure function (briefly, a regular -function) for in N if and only if it fulfills the following two conditions:

(a) for every in, $m(V)$ ∈ R;

(b) the sum i N i m(V)= 1 ∑ i of the values of m for all V in L is 1,. The regular m-function for V can N be extended to a regular m-function for the sentences in L by requiring the N following:

(a) for any L-false sentence j in, $m(j)= 0$ ;

(b) for any non-L-false N m(j)= ∑ $m(V)$ sentence j, (Carnap 1950: 295). $V\in R( j)$ In the example of the language system considered previously, a regular m-function for state descriptions is defined as follows:

m V = () ,fori= 1,3,4,7m V = () ,fori= 2,5,6,8.

It is extended to a regular m-function for sentences that assign numerical values to sentences, for example,

m(Pa \wedge \neg Pa) = 0; \quad m(Pa \vee \neg Pa) = 1

m(Pa \wedge Pb) = m(V_1) = \sum_{i=1,4}; \quad m(Pa \vee Pb) = m(V) = \sum_{i=1,2,3,4,6,7}

A regular confirmation function is defined as a two-argument function for sentences on the basis of a regular m-function for sentences in. Namely, let m be a N regular -function for sentences in N, then is a regular confirmation function (briefly, a regular c-function) for sentences in if and only if for any sentences e,h N in, N

$m(e\land h)$ c(h,e)= , m(e) where $m(e)\neq0$ and c(h,e) has no value, where $m(e)= 0$ (Carnap 1950: 295). e P a∧ Pa In the aforementioned example, if stands for the L-false sentence ‘ ’, is not defined for any hypothesis h. L-false sentences cannot be evidence for or c(h,e) against any hypothesis. However, if an L-false sentence, for example, ‘P a∧ Pa’, is taken as hypothesis h, then c(h,e)= 0 for any admissible piece of evidence e. Consider an L-true sentence, such as ‘ $Pa\lor Pa$ ’, as hypothesis h. Then c(h,e)= 1 no matter what the admissible evidence might be; no evidence can increase or decrease the degree of confirmation of a logical truth (obviously, eis not L-false). In other cases, for example, for the hypothesis h, ‘P a’ and the evidence e, ‘Pb’, $m(Pa\land Pb)$ c(P a,Pb)= 1 /6 = $m(Pb) = 1$ /2. A regular -function is a conditional probability function in the common parlance of mathematical theory of probability, since it satisfies Kolmogorov’s axioms. This was a desideratum for Carnap, who stipulated that an adequate concept of degree of confirmation should fulfill the following conditions (1950: 285):

(a) L-equivalent evidences. If e and e’ are L-equivalent, then c(h,e)= c(h,e’). (b) L-equivalent hypotheses. If h and h’ are L-equivalent, then c(h,e)= c(h’,e). (c) General Multiplication Principle. c(h∧ j,e)= c(h,e)∙c(j,e∧ h). (d) Special Addition Principle. If $e\land h\land j$ is L-false, then c(h∨ j,e)= c(h,e)+c( j,e) (e) Maximum Value. For any not L-false e c(t,e)= 1, where h, h’, e, e’,j are any sentences in and t is a logical truth. N Conditions

(a) and

(b) demand that the explicatum of the degree of confirmation should respect logical equivalence. The General Multiplication Principle is derived mathematically directly from the definition of conditional probability. The Special Addition Principle is recognized as the additivity axiom in Kolmogorov’s formulation, which gives rise to the finite additivity condition, and the Maximum Value condition corresponds to the fact probability of the sample space is 1. To recover unconditional probability functions for sentences in, Carnap N suggested considering the probability of any sentence conditionally to a tautology. c L j L Namely, if is a regular confirmation function for N, then for every sentence in N, the null confirmation is $c (j)$ = c( j,t). Moreover, he showed that $c (j)= m(j)$ . The null confirmation represents the prior probability of a sentence in the absence of any evidence (1950: 307-8). The example of the language system considered previously used a regular -function that assigned different real numbers to different state descriptions, that is, to different states in the universe of discourse. However, is there any reason to believe that these numbers should be unequal? Is there any reason to believe that one state description weighs more than any other? Rather, by application of the principle of indifference, it seems that one should demand equal distribution of weight to all state descriptions,

+(V)= ζ

where ζ is the number of the state descriptions in (Carnap, 1950: 564). Moreover, N it is easy to show that for any given piece of evidence e and for every pair of state description V,V compatible with e, it holds i j +(Vj,e) +(Vi,e)= c.

Of course, the principle of indifference entails equiprobability only for state descriptions and not for all sentences, in a way that Keynes would appreciate, since he was the first to suggest restricted application of the principle of indifference to possibilities that are mutually exclusive and exhaustive of the sample space, to avoid the Book paradox. Salmon (1966: 72) notes that Carnap’s “explication of probability in these terms has been thought to preserve the ‘valid core’ of the traditional principle of indifference.” Nevertheless, Carnap has shown that to suggest a regular m-function for V in L that assigns equal weight to all state descriptions, although intuitively plausible, has deeply undesirable consequences: it inhibits learning from experience. To see why, consider a language, with a single unary atomic predicate P. One wants to calculate the degree of confirmation of the hypothesis that the $(N + 1)$ -th individual will have the property P, that is, $h: P a_{N+1}$ , given the evidence that all N individuals examined so far had the property P, that is, $e: P a_1 \wedge \ldots \wedge P a_N$ . The number of state descriptions is $2^{N+1}$ , hence, the regular m-function assigns equal weight to all state descriptions, $m(V) = 1/2^{N+1}$ . First, notice that $h \wedge e$ and $\neg h \wedge e$ are state descriptions; hence, $m(h \wedge e) = m(\neg h \wedge e) = 1/2^{N+1}$ .

Second, sentences $e$ and $(h \wedge e) \vee (\neg h \wedge e)$ are L-equivalent. By the L-equivalent-hypotheses condition,

c(e, t) = c((h \wedge e) \vee (\neg h \wedge e), t)

and

m(e) = m((h \wedge e) \vee (\neg h \wedge e))

by the Special Addition Principle,

m(e) = m(h \wedge e) + m(\neg h \wedge e) = \frac{1}{2^{N+1}} + \frac{1}{2^{N+1}} = \frac{2}{2^{N+1}}

Hence,

c(h, e) = \frac{m(h \wedge e)}{m(e)} = \frac{1/2^{N+1}}{2/2^{N+1}} = \frac{1}{2}

Moreover, by a simple calculation,

m(h) = \sum_{V \in R(h)} m(V) = 2^N \cdot \frac{1}{2^{N+1}} = \frac{1}{2}

that is, $c(h, e) = c(h, t) = \frac{1}{2}$ .

The last equality yields the desired conclusion: the degree of confirmation of a hypothesis is independent of the evidence collected in a given population. No matter how many positive instances of a given property one observes in a population, their guess regarding the appearance of the property in the next individual is not better justified than if no observations were made; thus, learning does not come from experience (1950: 564-5). To avoid this difficulty, Carnap went on to apply the principle of indifference in a different way. Instead of distinguishing states of affairs in terms of properties and relations instantiated by certain individuals, Carnap grouped all states of affairs instantiating the same properties and relations independently of the individuals that instantiated them, and he distinguished only among these classes. Hence, one should not focus anymore on state descriptions describing possible states of the universe of discourse for a language system but on classes of such state descriptions in which any two state descriptions are isomorphic to one another. Two sentences i,j in L are N isomorphic if j is formed from i by replacing each individual constant occurring in i by its correlate with respect to a one-to-one relation among all individual constants in L. These classes are called structure descriptions, Str. They describe the common N structure attributed to the realm of individuals by a class of state descriptions. For instance, a structure description may express the fact that there are exactly two P individuals in the universe of discourse possessing a given property or that none of R R the individuals bears the relation to itself, or that relation is satisfied by pairs of individuals non-symmetrically, that is, if for all individual constants a,bRab and Rba are both satisfied, and so forth. Now the principle of indifference applies in two stages: firstly, equal weight is assigned to all structure descriptions and, secondly, within each structure description, equal weight is assigned to all isomorphic state V L τ descriptions. Thus, for a state description i in a language system N, if is the ζ number of structure descriptions Str and is the number of all state descriptions that are isomorphic to i, the regular -function for is defined as (1950: 564):

m (V)= . τ∙ζ

To illustrate the relation between state descriptions and structure descriptions and +,m the difference between the values of m regular m-functions, consult the following L P table, which represents the example of 3 with a single predicate: STATE STRUCTURE + WEIGHT WEIGHT DESCRIPT IONS DESCRIPT IONS $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 All Ps, no Ps 1 /4 1 /8 1 /4 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 1 /8 1 /12 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 2Ps, 1 P 1 /4 1 /8 1 /1 2 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 1 /8 1 /12 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 1 /8 1 /1 2 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 1 P, 2 P 1 /4 1 /8 1 /12 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 1 /8 1 /1 2 $Pa\land Pb\land Pc$ 1 /8 No Ps, all Ps 1 /4 1 /8 1 /4

One can now revisit the problem of determining the degree of confirmation of the th P a hypothesis that the ( $N+1$ ) individual will have the property P, that is, h: ‘ ’, $N+ 1$ given the evidence that all individuals examined so far had the property P, that is, e: ‘ P a ∧ … ∧ P a L P N 1’ in a language $N+1$ with a single unary predicate. Since the language contains $N+1$ individual constants, a structure description is determined by the number of instances of the property P found in the universe of discourse disregarding the identity of the individuals that instantiate the property. Thus, all state P a ∧ P a ∧ … ∧ P a descriptions that are isomorphic to ‘ ’ correspond to the same $N+ 1$ N− 1 1 structure description characterized by $N+1$ property instances in the universe of discourse, while all state descriptions that are isomorphic to ‘ P a ∧ P a ∧ … ∧ P a ’ correspond to the same structure description $N+ 1$ N− 1 1 characterized by property instances in the universe of discourse. Thus, there are different structure description corresponding to 0,1,…,N+1 occurrences of P, and the total number of structure descriptions is $τ= N+2$ . To calculate the number ζ of k state descriptions that are isomorphic to, let k to denote the number of occurrences k of P in V, that is, $k= 0$ ,1,…,N+1. Then ζ is the number of the different ways that k k N+1 ( $N+1$ )! = N individuals can form k-tuples, that is, () k. Thus, k!( $N+1$ − k)!

k! (N+1 - k)! m V = ( k) (N+2)!

for $k= 0$ ,1,…,N+1.

The degree of confirmation of the hypothesis h given evidence e is

$m (h\land e)$ c (h,e)= . $m (e)$ Notice that $h\land e$ is isomorphic to any state description, and $N+1 (N+1$ )! $m (h\land e)$ = m V = ( N) = ( $N+2$ )!, N+2 while $h\land e$ is isomorphic to any state description, and N N! m ( $h\land e$ )= m V = () N. ( $N+2$ )!

As before, sentence e is L-equivalent to ( $h\land e)\lor ( h\land e$ ), and

N! m (e)= m (h\land e)+m ( h\land e)= = (N+1)!. N+1

Thus, m (h\land e) c (h,e)= N+1 = m (e) . N+2

Using the same reasoning, one may calculate, more generally, the degree of confirmation of the hypothesis that the ( $r+1$ )-th individual a will exhibit property $r+1$ P a P, that is, h: ‘ ’given the evidence that r individuals of the universe of discourse $r+1$ have exhibited so far the same property P, that is,e: ‘P a ∧ … ∧ P a ’, r 1 $m (h\land e)$ c (h,e)= $r+1 = m (e)$ . N+2 These results amount to the celebrated Laplace’s Rule of Succession, which in Carnap’s theory of inductive logic has become a theorem.

c. The Continuum of Inductive Methods

The examples so far have examined three different regular c-functions: one determined by arbitrarily assigning weight to state descriptions in L, with the other +,c two, c, determined by assigning equal weight to state and structure descriptions, respectively, on the basis of the principle of indifference. There are many alternative ways to assign such a weight to the different possibilities, and each one of them results in a different regular c-function yielding a different degree of confirmation c(h,e) for a given hypothesis h and evidence e in a language system L. Thus, there are many different inductive methods, actually a continuum of such possible methods (Carnap, 1952). For a given language system, each inductive method is characterized by the value of a non-negative real parameter λ. For a given λ, the degree of confirmation c(h,e) is fixed for any hypothesis h and with respect to any evidence e, and any two inductive methods have the same λ only if they agree on the value of c(h,e). λ To understand how the degree of confirmation is defined in terms of the -parameter first requires explaining the concept of the logical width of a property (1950: 126-127). Consider any language system having π unary atomic predicates. N One may form molecular predicates by taking the conjunction of π predicates, which π are either the atomic predicates or their negations. In this way one forms $κ= 2$ F L molecular predicates (Q-predicates). Then any property expressible in N is represented either by a Q-predicate or by a disjunction of two or more Q-predicates. Logical width characterizes the logical complexity of a property F. The greater the logical width of a property, the greater the number of possible (non-contradictory) P ∨ P P properties it admits. For example, the property is wider than, since property $P \land P$ is admitted by the first but excluded by the second. Thus, the logical width of a contradictory property is, while the logical width of a property 1 F represented by a Q-predicate is. Any property that is expressed as a disjunction of Q-predicate has a logical width κ≥w>1 equal to the number of disjuncts. Moreover, the relative width F is the ratio w/κ. Notice that the relative width varies from 0, for a contradictory property, through ½, for any property represented by an atomic predicate, to 1 for a logically necessary property. Let e be the sentence expressing that, out of s individuals examined, s had F F h property, and let be the hypothesis that a given individual different that those F c(h,e) examined so far had also, then the degree of confirmation is

s c(h,e)= (s F) s+λ λ + (s w) s+λ, κ

s /s F λ where F is the relative frequency of observed instances of the property and a non-negative real number (Burks, 1953). The relative frequency of observed s /s instances, is an empirical fact, while the relative width of the property is a F logical fact depending on the language system and the predicate that represents the property. Hence, the degree of confirmation is determined as a mixture of a logical factor and of an empirical factor (1952: 24):

s F c(h,e)= (1− a) w +a s, κ λ a= where w c(h,e)=. If no observation has taken place, that is, $s= 0$ , then $s+ λ$ , and κ the degree of confirmation is determined on logical grounds. As the number of observations increases, relative frequency of observed instances acquires significance, s F and the degree of confirmation tends toward. Exactly how fast one learns from s s F experience, which is how fast c(h,e) tends to, depends on λ. The following table s summarizes the degrees of confirmation that correspond to different characteristic values of λ: λ c(h,e) s F s s +w F κ s+κ w λ→ ∞ κ

For $λ= 0$ , the straight rule stipulates that the observed relative frequency is equal to the probability that an unobserved individual has the property in question. Carnap says that the straight rule is problematic, since it yields complete certainty ( $c= 1$ if all examined individuals are found to possess the relative property ( $s = s$ )—a F s conclusion that may be accepted if the size of the sample is quite large but not $λ= κ$ otherwise (1950: 227). The second row in the table () is better interpreted if one assumes that the language system consists of one atomic unary predicate only. Then $w= 1 κ= 2$ c(h,e)= c (h,e) and, and one gets Laplace’s rule of succession,. Finally, with the same assumptions about the language system, for λ→ ∞, the logical factor +(h,e)= reigns and (h,e)= c 2, as calculated for equiprobable state descriptions. How can one decide which of the uncountable infinity of inductive methods is the appropriate one? Carnap’s answer is based on two important elements:

(a) adopting an inductive method is a matter of a choice that one make; and

(b) this choice is made on a priori grounds. Carnap agreed with Burks’ suggestion to apply to induction the internal-external distinction concerning the adoption of frameworks (1963: 982). Thus, while the degree of confirmation for a given hypothesis on given evidence is an internal question, it presupposes the adoption of a c-function, the choice of which is an external one, that is, it is raised outside any inductive system and has to do with the choice of a framework similar to the choice of a language system. Richard Jeffrey (1992: 28) pointed out that “Carnap counted the specification of -functions among the semantical rules for languages. Choice of a language was a framework question, a practical choice that could be wise or foolish, and lucky or unlucky, but not true or false.”

The pragmatic (that is, non-cognitive) nature of the scientist’s choice of an inductive method becomes apparent in the following passage: “ may change this instrument [i.e., their inductive method] just as he changes a saw or an automobile, and for similar reasons” (Carnap 1952: 55).

It is up to the scientists to make up their minds and to choose among them the one that they feel is most appropriate for their purposes. They can change them as they change their automobiles! Assuming that a choice of an inductive method has been made and a particular – c(h,e)= p function has been defined, any statement of the sort “ ” for specified sentences h,e, is analytic, if true (and contradictory, if false), that is, their truth or falsity rests on definition and pure logic. This fact raises additional problems regarding the justification of the applicability of the inductive methods to practical issues: “The question is,” says Salmon (1966:76), “How can statements that say nothing about any matters of fact serve as ‘a guide of life’?” The observation that non-trivial empirical content is introduced by the synthetic sentence e, which expresses evidence of past experience, does not improve things very much, for one may further require a justification of considering past evidence and logico-mathematical facts about the degree of a confirmation as a guide to predictions and one’s future conduct. On what grounds does one deem such a practice rational? Nevertheless, these last questions seem to get outside the limits of any framework since they are reformulations of the external question about the choice of a particular -function and can be answered neither from reason nor from experience. Where does all this leave Carnap’s project? The project of specifying the inductive logic falls apart. There is no uniquely rational way to determine the relations between evidence and hypotheses. Instead, Carnap’s attitude seems to be captured by the following paraphrase of Chairman Mao’s famous dictum: ‘Let a hundred inductive methods bloom’. But even if one were to argue that one ends up with a plurality of inductive methods, they would still fall short of being inductive logics. As was seen, the c-function depends on the parameter . But, as Howson and Urbach (1989: 55) have stated, the very idea of an adjustable parameter  “calls into question the fundamental role assigned to his systems of inductive logic by Carnap. If their adequacy is itself to be decided empirically, then the validity of whatever criterion we use to assess that adequacy is in need of justification, not something to be accepted uncritically.”

5. Subjective Probability and Bayesianism

a. Probabilities as Degrees of Belief

Subjective theory is a theory of inductive probability proposed by the Cambridge Apostle F. P. Ramsey in his paper “Truth and Probability,” written in 1926 and published in 1931, and, independently, by the Italian mathematician Bruno de Finetti, who proposed it somewhat later, in 1928, and published it in a series of papers in 1930. In this conception, probability is the degree of belief of an individual at a given time. The inductive nature of the account is reflected in de Finetti’s view (1972: 21) that “[t]he subjectivists… maintain that a probability evaluation, being but a measure of someone’s beliefs, is not susceptible of being proved or disproved by the facts.” A major assumption of the theory is that beliefs, commonly conceived as psychological states, are measurable, otherwise, as Ramsey put it, “all our inquiry will be vain” (1926:166). Thus, one needs to specify a method of measuring belief to consider the sentence ‘the degree of belief of X, at time t, is p’ meaningful. Ramsey examined two such methods. The first one is based on the fact that the degree of belief is perceptible by its owner, since one ascribes different intensities of feelings of conviction to different beliefs that they hold. However, as Ramsey noted, one does not have strong feelings for things one takes for granted (actually, such things are practically accompanied by no feeling), thus, this way of measuring degree of belief seems inadequate. The second method rests on the supposition that the degree of belief is a causal property and “the difference [in the degree of belief] seems… to lie in how far we should act on these beliefs” (ibid: 170).

To measure beliefs as the bases for actions, Ramsey (ibid: 172) “propose[d] a bet and see what are the lowest odds which… [the agent] will accept.”

In a similar vein, de Finetti (1931) characterized probability as “the psychological sensation of an individual” and also suggested using bets to measure degrees of belief. A bet on a hypothesis h, with betting quotient p, at stake S, bet(h,p,S), is defined by the following conditions:

(a) if hypothesis h is true, the gambler wins (1 − p)S;

(b) if hypothesis h is false, the gambler loses pS, where p is any real number in the unit interval and S any sum of money. The odds in a bet on h at stake S are R:Q whenever the betting quotient $p= R$ /( $R+Q$ ). h AGENT AGENT RECEIVES NET PAY OFF FOR THE AGENT PAY S T pS S (1− p)S F pS 0 − pS

The actions that measure an agent’s degree of belief in a hypothesis h are the buying and selling of a bet on h. In particular, the degree of belief of an individual X in a hypothesis h is a number p, which, expressed in monetary values, $p, is

(i) the highest price $1 is willing to buy a bet that returns h if is true $0, and h if is false, and, (ii) the lowest price is willing to sell that same bet. To better understand this definition, consider the set of all bets on h at stake $1. It can be characterized in terms of the betting quotients as follows:

\{p \in \mathbb{R}: bet(h, p, \$1)\}

To buy any bet from this collection, the bettor should pay $p. But, depending on h they are not willing to pay any amount of money; on the contrary, they seek to pay the least possible. The definition assumes that the amount of money the agent is willing to pay to buy the bet is bounded from above and its least upper bound is $p. Similarly, the money an agent could earn from selling the bet is bounded from below and the greatest lower bound is also $p. This number p is the degree of belief of an agent X in h. On this view, the conditional degree of belief of an individual in a hypothesis given some statement e, $b_X(h|e) = p$ , is defined in terms of the following bet at stake $1:

(a) if hypothesis $h \wedge e$ is true, the bettor wins $(1 – p);

(b) if hypothesis e is false, the bettor loses $p. The idea for this bet is that it is called off if e is false and the agent gets a refund of $p (Jeffrey 2004: 12). The degree of belief p of an individual X in a hypothesis h is confined within the p <0 unit interval. To see this, assume, first, that and consider the agent selling a bet to the bookie that pays $1 if h is true and $0 if h is false, for $p. Independently of h the truth-value of, this bet is a loss for the agent: the agent has a net gain of $(− 1 + p)<0 in case h is true and $p <0 in case h is false. In a similar vein, if p >1, an agent buying a bet from the bookie that pays $1 if h is true and $0 if h is false, for $p, gains $(1− p)<0 if h is true and $− p <0 if h is false, and the bet is, again, a loss for the agent. Hence, if an agent assigns to any of their beliefs degrees that are either negative or greater than 1, they are exposed to a betting situation with guaranteed loss independently of the truth or the falsity of that belief. Such an unwelcome bet or set of bets which “will with certainty result in a loss” (de Finetti, 1974: 87) for the agent is called a Dutch book. It is conjectured that the term can be traced back to the introduction of the Lotto game in the Low Countries, at the beginning of the 16th century, where, in the so-called “Dutch Lotto,” the organizer had, in any event, a positive gain (de Finetti, 2008: 45). Hence, to avoid a Dutch book, one should confine degrees of belief within the interval [0,1 ]. A degree of belief function b is an assignment of degrees of belief of a person X’s beliefs as represented by propositions (or classes of logically equivalent sentences, in a language dependent context): S ∋ h↦ b (h)∈ [0,1 ]. For an agent X with an assignment of d egrees of belief described by the function b, one may define the expected winnings of a bet(h, p,S) for X, as a convex combination of the gains and losses of the agent on this bet with coefficients determined by their degree of belief in h: EW [bet(h, p,S),X]= $b (h)V (h)+ 1 - b (h) V( h) X ( X)$ where $V (h)$ is the net payoff for the agent if h is true, and $V ( h)$ is the net payoff if h is false. To understand this concept, think of $V (h)$ and $V ( h)$ as the possible states in which an agent whose belief function assigns 1 and 0 to h, respectively, expects to be found if the bet offered is accepted. Namely, an agent that is certain of the truth of h expects to gain $V (h)$ , and an agent that is certain of the falsity of h expects to gain $V ( h)$ by accepting the bet. If the agent’s belief function assigns any other number in h V (h) the unit interval to, they will occupy an intermediate state. Geometrically, and $V ( h)$ may be thought of as the extremities of a line segment and any other state a point between these extremities. Next, assume that the agent is placed on the midpoint of the segment, equidistant from its extremities. Then the bet does not give any prevalence beforehand to the truth or the falsity of the hypothesis for that particular agent, and it is fair. If the agent’s belief function places them closer to either of the extremities, $V (h)$ or $V ( h)$ , then this gives an unfair advantage for or against h, for $b (h)$ = p this agent. Thus, for X 0, the expected winnings of a bet(h, p,S) for X is p − p S (), and it measures how fair or unfair the bet is for that particular agent. In this understanding, no commitment to a probabilistic view of the belief function is required. It is sufficient to treat belief quantitatively, to consider the degree of belief for a hypothesis as a number in the closed interval and to interpret the values 0 and 1 in terms of the belief in the falsity and truth of the hypothesis, respectively. Accordingly, one may now give the following definitions:  Bet(h,p,S) is a fair bet for X if and only if EW bet(h, p,S),X = 0. [ ]  Bet(h,p,S) is advantageous for X if and only if EW [bet(h,p,S),X]>0.  Bet(h,p,S) is disadvantageous for X if and only ifEW bet(h,p,S),X <0. [ ] Notice that the Dutch book in which one would be vulnerable were one to consider degrees of belief outside the unit interval is fair, since it is defined in terms of buying and selling bet(h,p,S)— a fact that makes its bite even worse.

b. Dutch Books

Ramsey identified a connection between Dutch books and the laws of mathematical probability. In “Truth and Probability” he says (1926: 182) “[i]f anyone’s mental condition violated these laws [of probability]… [h]e could have a book made against him by a cunning bettor and would then stand to lose in any event.”

And conversely, “[h]aving degrees of belief obeying the laws of probability implies a further measure of consistency, namely such a consistency between the odds acceptable on different propositions as shall prevent a book being made against you” (1926: 183). Instead of Ramsey’s ‘consistency,’ de Finetti (1974: 87) has spoken of ‘coherence’ of degrees of beliefs. The degrees an agent assigns to his beliefs are said to be coherent “if among the combinations of bets which [y]ou have committed yourself to accepting there are none for which the gains are all uniformly negative.” Thus, if an agent is not vulnerable to a Dutch book with betting quotients equal to their degrees of belief, the agent is said to have coherent degrees of belief. In addition, an agent has coherent degrees of belief if and only if their degrees of belief satisfy the axioms of probability. This is the celebrated Ramsey-de Finetti or Dutch-Book theorem: b:S ⟶ R Let X Lbe a degree of belief function X b of a person. If Xdoes not satisfy the axioms of probability, then there is a family of fair bets bet h,p,S, with $h \in S$ , p= b h ( i i i) i L i X( i), and $S\in R$ , for every $i= 1$ ,…,n (or ∞) which guarantees that the agent will result in an overall loss, independently of h the truth-values of the hypotheses i. The converse of that theorem has also been shown: Let b:S ⟶ Rbe a degree of belief function of a person X. If b satisfies the axioms of probability, then there is no family of fair bets bet(h,p,S), with h ∈ S p= b h, (), $S\in R$ and, for every $i= 1$ ,…,n which guarantees that the agent will result in an overall loss, independently of the truth-values of the h hypotheses i. This article has already discussed the application of the Ramsey-de Finetti theorem in the case of violation of the axiomatically imposed constraint that probability values lie within the unit interval. The next example illustrates how an agent will experience an overall loss if they hold degrees of belief that do not comply with the finite additivity axiom. Consider the tossing of a die and assume that the degrees of belief assigned by a X q person to the beliefs that they will obtain ‘6’ in a single toss is, ‘3’ in a single toss is r, and either ‘6’ or ‘3’ is k. Moreover, let $k<r+q$ , that is, the finite additivity axiom is violated. Then one may consider the following family of fair bets, suggested to the agent: ‘ ‘ ‘ bet(‘6‘,q,1),bet(‘3‘,r,1),bet(‘6 or3,k,− 1).

In the following table is calculated the net gain for the agent in this betting sequence:

‘6’	‘3’	‘6’ OR ‘3’	NET GAIN FOR THE AGENT
T	F	T	$(1 - q)\cdot 1 + (- r)\cdot 1 + (1 - k)(- 1) = k - (r+q)$
F	T	T	$(- q)\cdot 1 + (1 - r)\cdot 1 + (1 - k)(- 1) = k - (r+q)$
F	F	F	$(- q)\cdot 1 + (- r)\cdot 1 + (- k)(- 1) = k - (r+q)$

As can be seen, this sequence of bets results in an overall loss for the agent. Thus, as the Ramsey-de Finetti theorem demands, an agent whose degree of belief function violates the axiom of finite additivity is exposed to a Dutch book. One could obtain a similar result for the violation of the counta ble additivity axiom. In this case, one needs to emp loy a counta ble infinite family of bets. Howeve r, a criticism that follows such a n assump tion is that it is unrealistic for any agent to be eng aged in infinitely many bets (Jeffrey,2 004: 8). There have been attempts to extend the requirement of coherence from the synchronic case, as expressed by the compliance of the degrees of belief with the axioms of probability theory, to diachronic coherence by stipulating rules for belief updating. Learning from experience requires that the agent should change their assignment of degree of belief (probability) for a given hypothesis in response to the result of experiment or observation. The simplest, and most common, rule for updating is the following: In the light of new evidence, the agent should update their degrees of beliefs by conditionalizing on this evidence. Thus, assume that the belief function of a person X before new evidence e is acquired is b Xold and b Xnew is the belief function after the acquisition of new evidence. The transition from the old degree of belief to the new one is governed by the rule

b_{X_{\text{new}}}(h) = b_{X_{\text{old}}}(h | e)

where e is the total evidence and $b (h\lor e)$ is the posterior probability as determined Xold by Bayes’s Theorem if one identifies the degree of belief function with the probability function. This form of conditionalization is called strict conditionalization, and it takes the probability of the learned evidence to be unity, that is, $b (e)= 1$ . Jeffrey found out Xnew that certainty is a very restrictive condition that does not conform with the uncertainties of real empirical research in science and everyday life. To show that, Jeffrey suggested the example of observing the color of a piece of cloth by candlelight. The agent gets the impression that the observed color is green, but they concede that it may be blue or, less probably, violet. The experience causes a change to the agent’s degree of belief in propositions about the color of the object but does not cause the agent to change it to 1. Hence, strict conditionalization is inapplicable for updating degrees of belief. Jeffrey suggested another form of conditionalization that tackles this problem, known as Jeffrey-conditionalization (or, probability kinematics, as Jeffrey called it), which considers evidence as providing probabilities to a partition of one’s set of beliefs. In this case, the new degree of belief function is calculated in terms of the old one, n b (h)= ∑ $b (h\lor e)$ p Xnew Xold i, where $\{e_i\}_{i=1}^n$ is a partition of one’s set of beliefs consisting of mutually exclusive and p= b e,i= 1,…,n jointly exhaustive propositions, and (), are the probabilities i Xnew i e assigned to propositions by new evidence. As before, $b (h\lor e)$ is calculated as i Xold i the posterior probability in Bayes’s Theorem. One difficulty with Jeffrey’s conditionalization is that, while strict conditionalization provides an assurance of convergence to truth, Jeffrey’s conditionalization generally does not. There is a family of theorems, known as convergence theorems, with the most well-known being that of Gaifman and Snir (1982), which claim that, under reasonable assumptions, the probability of a hypothesis conditional on available evidence converges to 1 within the limits of empirical research, if the hypothesis is true. These theorems provide a vindication of Bayesianism, showing that it is guaranteed to find the truth eventually by applying successively strict conditionalization. Conditionalizing on the evidence is a purely logical updating of degrees of belief. It is not ampliative. It does not introduce new content, nor does it modify any old content. It just assigns a new degree of belief to an old opinion. The justification for the requirement of conditionalization is supposed to be a diachronic version of the Dutch-book theorem. It is supposed to be a canon of rationality (certainly a necessary condition for it) that agents should update their degrees of belief by conditionalizing on evidence. The penalty for not doing this is liability to a Dutch-book strategy: the agent can be offered a set of bets over time such that a) each of them taken individually will seem fair to them at the time it is offered, but b) taken collectively, they lead them to suffer a net loss, come what may.

c. Bayesian Induction

In this context, induction rests on the degree of belief one assigns to a hypothesis given a body of confirmatory evidence and on the process of updating the belief in the light of new evidence. Hence, the problem of justification of induction gives way to the problem of justifying conditionalization on the evidence. In general, Bayesian theories of confirmation maintain the following theses:

(a) Belief is always a matter of degree; degrees of belief are probability values and degree of belief functions are probability functions.

(b) Confirmation is a relation of positive relevance, namely, a piece of evidence confirms a hypothesis if it increases its probability; e confirmsh if and only if $p(h\lor e)$ > $p(h)$ , where p is a probability function. Similarly, one may define disconfirmation of a $p(h|e)$ < $p(h)$ , hypothesis by a piece of evidence in terms of negative relevance () as well as the neutrality of a hypothesis with respect to a piece of evidence in terms of irrelevance ( $p(h|e)= p(h)$ ).

(c) The relation of confirmation is captured by Bayes’s theorem, which dictates the change of the degree of belief in a given hypothesis in the light of a piece of evidence, $p(e|h)p(h) p(h|e)$ = ,wherep(h),p (e)>0. p(e)

(d) The only factors relevant to confirmation of a hypothesis are its prior probability $p(h)$ , the likelihood of the evidence given the hypothesis $p(e|h)$ , and the probability of the evidence $p(e)$ .

(e) The specification of the prior probability of (prior degree of belief in) a hypothesis is a purely subjective matter.

(f) The only (logical-rational) constraint on an assignment of prior probabilities to several hypotheses should be that they obey the axioms of the probability calculus.

(g) The reasonableness of a belief does not depend on its content nor, ultimately, on whether the belief is made reasonable by the evidence.

d. Too Subjective?

In 1954, Savage discussed a criticism of subjective Bayesianism based on the idea that science or scientific method aims at finding out “what is probably true, by criteria on which all reasonable men agree” (1954:67). By applying intersubjectively accepted criteria, scientific method is supposed to lead to an agreement between any two rational agents on the probability for the truth of a hypothesis given the same body of evidence. According to Savage, this demand for intersubjectivity has its source either in considering probabilistic entailment as a generalization of logical entailment or in considering probability an objective property of certain physical systems. Yet, the criticism goes, complete freedom in the choice of prior probabilities for a hypothesis by two agents may yield different posterior probabilities for that hypothesis given the same body of evidence. This fact compromises the desideratum of intersubjectivity of criteria since it makes room for the intrusion of idiosyncratic elements, non-cognitive values, or any other source of subjective preferences, reflected in the disagreement of the agents in the choice of priors, and, ultimately, in the value of posterior probability of a hypothesis. Hence, what is “probably true” is not evaluated by “criteria on which all people agree.” In a nutshell, it is claimed that purely subjective prior probabilities fail to capture the all-important notion of rational or reasonable degrees of belief and that subjective Bayesianism is too subjective to offer an adequate theory of confirmation. In defense of subjective probability, Savage claims that, although this view incorporates all the universally acceptable criteria for reasonableness in judgement… [these criteria] do not guarantee agreement on all questions among all honest and freely communicating people, even in principle (ibid), considering disagreements a non-distressful situation. Moreover, anticipating what later became known as convergence-to-certainty or merger-of-opinions theorems, he showed that “in certain contexts any two opinions, provided that neither is extreme in a technical sense, are almost sure to be brought very close to one another by a sufficiently large body of evidence” (1954: 68; see also 46f).

Yet, as Hesse (1975; see also Earman 1992:143) objected, Savage’s argument makes assumptions that are valid for the flipping of a coin case but are not typically valid in scientific inference. Gaifman and Snir (1982) have shown important results which overcome the limitations of Savage’s account. They have shown (Theorem 2.1) that for an infinite sequence of empirical questions, φ,…, φ,…, formulated in a given 1 n language that satisfies certain conditions:

 Convergence-to-certainty: The limiting probability of a true sentence ψ in that language, given all empirical evidence collected in the world w, in response w w to empirical questions stated, equals to 1, φ,…,φ,… 1 n w lim Pr⁡( $ψ\lor φ$ )= 1 i≤ n i. For a false proposition, the respective probability is 0, n→ ∞ w lim Pr⁡( $ψ\lor φ$ )= 0. i≤ n i n→ ∞  Merger-of-opinions: The distance between any two probability functions that agree to assign probability 0 to the same sentences, that is, they are equally dogmatic, converges to 0, in the limit of empirical research, that is, w w lim |Pr ⁡( $ψ \lor φ$ )− Pr ⁡( φ)|= 0. ψ 1 i≤n i 2 i≤ n i n→ ∞ The merger-of-opinions theorem is supposed to mitigate the excessive subjectivity of Bayesianism in the choice of prior probabilities: the actual values assigned to prior probabilities do not matter much since they ‘wash out’ in the long run. Unfortunately, several criticisms of the theorem show that the objection of subjectivism is not fully addressed. The first criticism is related to the asymptotic character of convergence and merging and the fact that the speed of convergence is unknown. The results do not apply to the divergences of opinion induced by small-and medium-sized sets of evidence that have practical importance. The second criticism is related to the language-dependent nature of the theorems, which restricts them to cases in which the predicates of the language are fixed. The theorems cannot guarantee washing out the priors assigned by agents in different linguistic contexts, as before and after a scientific revolution. An important criticism stems from the fact that convergence in the theorems is obtained almost everywhere, that is, for all worlds w, the actual world included, which belong to some set of possible worlds with probability 1. In the authors’ own words:

[W]ith probability 1, two persons holding mutually nondogmatic initial views will, in the long run, judge similarly… Also the convergence is guaranteed with probability 1, where “probability” refers to the presupposed prior. (I) and (II) [referring to the two parts of the theorem] form an “inner justification” but they do not constitute a justification of the particular prior.

So, the theorem guarantees convergence to truth and merging of opinions in every world except for some pathological cases that form small sets of worlds of measure zero. But who decides what those sets of worlds of measure zero would be? The Bayesian agent themselves through the choice of priors who is compelled to assign probability zero to ‘unpleasant’ scenarios. On these grounds, Earman claims that the “impressiveness of these results disappears in the light of their narcissistic character… ‘almost surely’ sometimes serves as a rug under which some unpleasant facts are swept” (1992:147). Extending on this criticism, Belot (2013; 2017) has argued that, in problems of convergence to truth, there are typical cases—t heir typicality being defined in a topological sense without measure-theoretic presuppositions—i n which convergence to truth is unsuccessful, a fact that a Bayesian agent is bound to ignore by assigning prior probability zero to such cases. Thus, Belot concludes, convergence-merger theorems “constitute a real liability for Bayesianism by forbidding a reasonable epistemological modesty” (2013). Belot’s arguments have prompted a variety of responses: some philosophers were critical of Belot’s topological considerations as being irrelevant to probability theory (Cisewski et al. 2018; Huttegger 2015). Others focused on imprecise probabilities and finitely additive probabilities to escape the charge of immodesty (Weatherson 2015; Elga 2016; Nielsen and Stewart 2019). Huttegger (2021) has shown, using non-standard analysis, that “convergence to the truth fails with (non-infinitesimal) positive probability for certain hypotheses… [a fact] that creates a space for modesty within Bayesian epistemology.” As regards the countable additivity of the probability function, the convergence-to-certainty and merger-of-opinions theorems rely essentially on this axiom. Prominent subjective Bayesians, on the other hand, such as de Finetti and Savage, explicitly reject the countable additivity axiom despite its theoretical fecundity. Yet Savage, as mentioned above, has explored the possibility of theorems that, despite their shortcomings, attempt to mitigate the extreme subjectivism of Bayesianism. Recently, Nielsen (2021) has shown that there are uncountably many merely finitely additive probabilities that converge to the truth almost surely and in probability. As a general comment, it should be noted that the area convergence and merger theorems seem to have many open problems to capture the interest of researchers. e. Some Success Stories Bayesian theory has a record of successful justifications of some important common intuitions about confirmation, such as the belief that a theory is confirmed by its observational consequences or the belief that a theory is better confirmed if subject to strict tests, and it has provided a solution to the famous ‘raven paradox’. It is straightforward to show that hypotheses are confirmed by their consequences. Assume that $h⊢ e$ , then the likelihood of e given h is $p(e|h)= 1$ and according to $p(e|h)p(h)$ Bayes theorem, $p(h|e)= p(h) = p(e)$ > $p(h)$ , given that e is not trivially true ( $p(e) p(e)<1$ ); hence, e confirms h. This result justifies the inference of the truth of a hypothesis on the basis of its observational consequences, as the hypothetico-deductive method of confirmation suggests. Although the inference commits the formal fallacy of affirming the consequent, if considered inductively, through the lenses of Bayes’s theorem, it is fully justified, and the confirmatory nature of the hypothetico-deductive method is explained. This is what Earman recognized as an important “success story” of the Bayesian approach (1992: 233). Another common methodological intuition that may be justified on Bayesian grounds is related to the scientific practice of subjecting a hypothesis to severe tests on the basis of improbable consequences. As Deborah Mayo (2018: 14), following Popper, suggested in her Strong Severity Principle, “[w]e have evidence for a claim Cjust to the extent it survives a stringent scrutiny. If Cpasses a test that was highly capable of findings flaws or discrepancies from C, and yet none or few are found, the passing result, x, is evidence for C.”

e h h⊢ e Now, as before, consider a logical consequence of a hypothesis, that is,. A h severe test of would be one in which $p( e)$ is high and, consequently, $p(e)$ is low. In this case, e would be evidence for h. Hence, a necessary condition for collecting evidence for a hypothesis, according to the aforementioned principle, would be to test its improbable consequences. Indeed, following Bayes’s theorem, $p(e|h)p(h) p(h|e)= p(h) = p(e)$ . $p(e)$

Thus, the more improbable the consequence e is, the greater the degree of $p(h|e)$ confirmation, as measured by the ratio, is. $p(h)$ Another piece in the collection of trophies of the Bayesian account is the resolution of the raven paradox. This is a paradox of confirmation, first noted by Carl Hempel, which took its name from the example that Hempel used to illustrate it, namely, all ravens are black. The paradox emerges from the impossibility of having jointly satisfied three intuitively compelling principles of confirmation. The first is Nicod’s principle [named after the French philosopher Jean Nicod]: a universal generalization is confirmed by its positive instances. So, that all ravens are black is confirmed by the observation of black ravens. The second is the principle of logical equivalence: if a piece of evidence confirms a hypothesis, it also confirms its logically equivalent hypotheses. The third is the principle of relevant empirical investigation: hypotheses are confirmed by investigating empirically what they assert. h To set up the paradox, take the hypothesis: All ravens are black. The hypothesis ‘ h: All non-black things are non-ravens is logically equivalent to h. A positive ‘ instance of is a white piece of chalk. Hence, by Nicod’s condition, the observation h ‘ of the white piece of chalk confirms h. By the principle of equivalence, it also confirms h, that is, that all ravens are black. But then the principle of relevant empirical investigation is violated. For, the hypothesis that all ravens are black is confirmed not by examining the colour of ravens (or of any other birds) but by examining seemingly irrelevant objects (like pieces of chalk or red roses). So at least one of these three principles should be abandoned, if the paradox is to be avoided. To resolve the raven paradox, a Bayesian may show that there is no problem with accepting all three principles of confirmation since the degree of confirmation conferred on the hypothesis h by an instance of a non-raven-non-black object is negligible in comparison with how much the hypothesis is confirmed by an instance of a black object.(According to Howson and Urbach (2006: 100), a Bayesian analysis could also challenge the adequacy of Nicod’s criterion as a universal principle of confirmation.) h:∀ x(Rx→ Bx) h’:∀ x( Bx→ Rx) To see that, consider hypotheses and and ‘ evidence e: $Ra\land Ba$ and e: $Ba\land Ra$ , which are positive instances of h∧ h’ respectively. Then calculate the ratio $p(h|e)$ /p (h|e’), which according to Bayes’s e e’ h theorem and the easily verifiable equality of likelihoods of and given, $p(h|e) p(e|h)$ = p(e’|h), is $p(e)$ = ‘ (|) p h e ‘. But >> $p(e)$ because there are very many ‘ p(e) $p(e)$ more things which are non-Black and non-Ravens than Black Ravens. Hence, $p(h|e)$ ≫ p(h|e’), that is, e confirms ha lot more than e’ confirms h’. This discussion of subjective probability and Bayesian confirmation theory concludes by referring to what has become known as the old evidence problem. The problem was identified for the first time by Glymour (1980), and it underlines a potential conflict between Bayesianism and scientific practice. Suppose that a piece of evidence eis already known (that is, it is an old piece of evidence relative to the hypothesis h under test). Its probability, then, is equal to unity, $p(e)= 1$ . Given Bayes’s theorem, it turns out that this piece of evidence does not affect at all the posterior probability, $p(h\lor e)$ , of the hypothesis given the evidence; the posterior $p(h\lor e)= p(h)$ probability is equal to the prior probability, that is,. This, it is argued, is clearly wrong since scientists typically use known evidence to support their theories. This fact is demonstrated by the use of the anomalous precession of Mercury’s perihelion, discovered in the nineteenth century, as confirming evidence for Einstein’s General Theory of Relativity. Therefore, the critics conclude, there must be something wrong with Bayesian confirmation. Some Bayesians have replied by adopting a counterfactual account of the relation between theory and old evidence (Howson and Urbach 2006: 299). Suppose, they argue, that K is the relevant background knowledge and e is an old (known) piece of evidence—t hat is, e is actually part of K. In considering what kind of support e confers on a hypothesis h, one can subtract counterfactually the known evidence e from the background knowledge K. One e e therefore presumes that is not known and asks: what is the probability of given K{e\ e? This will be less than one; hence, the evidence can affect (that is, raise or lower) the posterior probability of the hypothesis.

6. Appendices

a. Lindenbaum Algebra and Probability in Sentential Logic.

This appendix shows how one can assign probabilities, originally defined in set-theoretic framework, to sentences in the language of sentential logic, L. It presents formulations of Kolmogorov’s axioms of probability for sentences and some important theorems. In particular, consider the set of all well-formed formulas (wffs) of L and define for every wff ϕ the equivalence class:

[\varphi] = \{\psi : \vdash_L \varphi \equiv \psi\}

In the set of all equivalence classes S, one can define set-theoretic operations that correspond to the sentential connectives of the language. Thus, for every two wffs ϕ,ψ:

$[\varphi] \cup [\psi] = [\varphi \vee \psi]$ ,
$[\varphi] \cap [\psi] = [\varphi \wedge \psi]$ ,
$\overline{[\varphi]} = [\neg \varphi]$ ,
$[\bot] = \emptyset$ ,
$[t] = \{\text{wffs of } L\}$

where “⊥ ” designates a contradiction and “t” a tautology. Constructed this way, the set of all equivalence classes, S, is a field (and a Boolean algebra) (see section 1a), and it is called Lindenbaum algebra (Hailperin 1986: 30ff.). However, since in the ϕ ∨ … ∨ ϕ ∨ … language of sentential logic, infinitary operations, like, cannot be 1 n applied to wffs ϕ to produce other wffs, one cannot define in S the countably infinite S union of classes of wffs. As a consequence, is not a σ-field, and the probability function about to be defined does not satisfy countable additivity. So, this is an account of elementary probability theory. To discuss the full axiomatic apparatus of probability theory, one needs to work in richer languages, which for present purposes is not deemed necessary. p So, one can define a probability function that satisfies Kolmogorov’s axioms (i)- S (iii) on and assign to each singular sentence of the language L the probability value of its equivalence class. Thus, for any sentences a,b and a tautotology t of L, $p(a)\geq0$

i. $p(a) \geq 0$ ;
ii. $p(t) = 1$ ;
iii. $p(a \vee b) = p(a) + p(b)$ , where $a \vdash_L \neg b$ .

As for the conditional probability of a sentences a given the truth of a sentence sentences b, we have:

p(a | b) = \frac{p(a \wedge b)}{p(b)}, \quad p(b) \neq 0

It is obvious from the discussion above that logically equivalent sentences have equal probability values: if ⊢ a≡ b, then $p(a)= p(b)$ .

This appendix concludes with some useful theorems of the probability calculus which are stated in sentence-based formalism, without proof:

1. The sum of the probability of a sentence and of its negation is 1: $p( a)= 1 - p(a)$ . ⊥ 2. Contradictions (have zero probability: p(⊥)= 0. 3. The probability function respects the entailment relation: $a⊢ b$ If, then $p(a)$ ≤ p(b). 4. Probability values range between 0 and 1: 0≤ p(a)≤1. 5. Finite Additivity Condition: p a ∨ $\dots \lor a$ = p a +… + p a,a ⊢ a,1 ≤i< j≤ N. () () () 1 N 1 N i L j Corollary: If ⊢ $a \lor \dots \lor a$ and a ⊢ a,1 ≤i< j≤N, 1 = $p(a)+\dots + p(a)$ . L 1 N i L j 1 N 6. Theorem of total probability: p a ∨ $\dots \lor a = 1$ a ⊢ a,i≠ j p(b)= p b∧ $a +\dots$ + p b∧ a If (1 N), and i L j, then (1) ( N), for any sentence b. Or in terms of conditional probabilities: p a ∨ $\dots \lor a = 1$ a ⊢ a,i≠ j p a >0 If (1 N), i L j, and ( i) then $p(b)$ = p b∨ a p a +… + p b∨ a p a () () () (), for any sentence b. 1 1 N N Corollary 1: $p(b)$ = p b∧ $a +\dots$ + p b∧ a If ⊢ $a \lor \dots \lor a$ and a ⊢ a,i≠ j, then () (). L 1 N i L j 1 N Corollary 2: $p(b)= p(b\lor c)p(c)+\dots +p (b\lor c) p( c)$ , for any sentence c,p(c)>0. 7. Bayes’s Theorem. The famous theorem that took its name after the eighteenth-century clergyman Thomas Bayes.  First form (Thomas Bayes): $p(h|e) = \frac{p(e|h) \cdot p(h)}{p(e)}$ , where $p(h), p(e) > 0$ where $p(h|e)$ is called posterior probability and expresses the probability of the hypothesis h conditional on the evidence e; $p(e|h)$ is called the likelihood of the hypothesis and expresses the probability of the evidence conditional on the hypothesis; $p(h)$ is called the prior probability of the hypothesis; and $p(e)$ is the probability of the evidence.  Second form (Pierre Simon Laplace): If $p(h \lor \dots \lor h)= 1$ and h ⊢ h,i≠ j, and $p(h)$ ,p(e)>0then 1 N i L j i p eh p(h) (| k) k p h e = ( k|) N p e h p(h) (|) ∑ i i i= 1  Third form:

p(h|e) = \frac{p(e|h) \cdot p(h)}{p(e|h) \cdot p(h) + p(e|\overline{h}) \cdot p(\overline{h})}

b. The Rule of Succession: a Mathematical Proof

Assume that you want to calculate the probability that the sun will rise tomorrow N given that the sun has risen for the past days. You have observation data about the N q sunrise in the past days, but the probability of the sunrise is unknown. By application of the principle of indifference, the claim is that it is equally likely that the probability of sunrise will be any number q∈ [0,1 ]. Hence, the distribution of probability values of sunrise is uniform. Take the sample space to consist of (N+2)-ples of the following type: $N+1$ ⏞S,S,…,F,…,S,q>,

where S,F stand for ‘Success’ and ‘Failure’ of the sunrise, respectively, and q denotes a possible value for the probability of the sun rising. The subset of the sample space, $E = \{\overbrace{S, \ldots, S}^N, x, q > x \in \{S, F\} \wedge q \in C\}$ [0,1 ],

is a random event consistent with observations of the sun rising in the past N days, no matter what is going to happen in the ( $N+1$ ) day or what the probability q of the sunrise is. Since parameter q takes real values, one should not ask what the probability of a given value k of the parameter q is, but what the probability of q to be found within a given interval is:

$p(q\leqk|E)$ .

To calculate this probability, first apply Bayes’s rule:

p(q \leq k | E) = \frac{p(q \leq k) \cdot p(E | q \leq k)}{p(E)}

Since all values of q in [0,1 ] are equiprobable,

p(q≤k)= k.

Since the sequence of past sunrises is a sequence of independent trials, that is, whether the sun has risen or not in a given day does not influence the rising of the sun in subsequent days, N k p(E|q≤k)= $N+1$ and $p(E)= N+1$ Hence: $N+ 1$ (|) p q≤k E = k.

From here, one can calculate the probability density function for $q= k$ conditional on E: N f(k)= ( $N+1$ )k.

To yield the probability of the sun to rise in the ( $N+1$ ) day, given that it has risen in the last N days, no matter what the probability of sunrise might be is given by the following integral,

\int_0^1 k \cdot f(k) \, dk = (N+1) \cdot \frac{k^{N+2}}{N+2} \Big|_0^1 = \frac{N+1}{N+2}

c. The Mathematics of Keynes’s Account of Pure Induction

e:this A is B Consider a generalization h:all A is Band n positive instances, $i= 1$ ,…,n that follow logically from h, that is, $h⊢ e$ . Let $p(h\lor K)$ be prior to any K evidence probability relative to background knowledge. Background knowledge is understood as the body of evidence which is related to the truth of the hypothesis, with the exception of the evidence that is being considered explicitly. If n positive e:this A is B $i= 1$ ,…,n instances i, and no negative instances have been observed, the h p h∨ $e \land \dots \land e \land K$ posterior probability of is (1 n). To justify inductive inference, Keynes claims, one needs to find the conditions on which the posterior probability increases with the accumulation of positive instances and the absence of negative instances so that the inductive argument is strengthened and, in the limit of empirical investigation, hypothesis h can be inferred with certainty on the basis of empirical evidence:

\lim_{n \to \infty} p(h | e_1 \wedge \ldots \wedge e_n \wedge K) = 1

From Bayes’s theorem, one has $p(h|K)$ p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h\land K ()$ 1 n p h∨ $e \land \dots \land e \land K$ = () 1 n. p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor K (1 n)$

h⊢ e Since, i= 1,\dots,n, p(e \land \dots \land e \lor h\land K)= 1 (1), 1 n

$p (h|K) p(h\lor e \land \dots \land e \land K)= 1 n (2)$ . p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor K ()$ 1 n From the law of total probability, one has p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor K$ = p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h$ ∧ K p( $h\lor K$ )+ p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h$ ∧ K p( $h\lor K$ ), () () () 1 n 1 n 1 n and by (1), p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor K = p(h\lor K)$ + p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h$ ∧ K p( $h\lor K$ )(3). (1 n) (1 n) Hence, by (2) and (3), $p(h|K)$ p h∨ $e \land \dots \land e \land K$ = (1 n) . p( $h\lor K$ )+ p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h$ ∧ K p( $h\lor K$ ) () 1 n

$p(e \land \dots \land e \lor h\land K)$ 1 n If lim n→ ∞ = 0, the requested condition of asymptotic certainty, $p(h\lor K)$ lim p h∨ $e \land \dots \land e \land K = 1$ () 1 n, is satisfied. Since $p(h|K)$ is the prior probability of the n→ ∞ hypothesis, which is independent of the evidence accumulated, it is a fixed number. Hence, the antecedent of the aforementioned conditional can be split into the following two conditions:

p(h|K)\neq0(4)

\lim_{n \to \infty} p(e_1 \wedge \ldots \wedge e_n | \neg h \wedge K) = 0 \quad (5)

e Condition (5) can be analyzed in terms of the probability of a positive instance j j− 1 h e ∧ … ∧ e h given positive instances for, 1 j− 1, and that is false:

p(e \lor e \land \dots \land e \land h\land K)= q,j= 2,\dots,n j 1 j- 1 j p e \lor h\land K = q. ()

The probability of n positive instances and no negative instances given that h is false is

p e ∧ $\dots \land e \lor h\land K$ = q ∙… ∙q. () 1 n 1 n n Let 1 > $M = max$ {q,…,q \, then $p(e \land \dots \land e \lor h\land K)$ ≤ M. The sequence n 1 n 1 n n M is bounded. If $0 < M < 1$ , then $\{q_n\}_{n \in \mathbb{N}}$ for every $n\in N$ , $p(e \land \dots \land e \lor h\land K)$ ≤ M <M, 1 n n and (5) follows: n lim $p(e \land \dots \land e \lor h\land K)$ ≤ lim $M = 0$ . 1 n n→ ∞ n→ ∞

By contraposition one infers that, if condition (5) is not satisfied, $\{q_n\}_{n \in \mathbb{N}}$ is not bounded by any number M, 0<M<1. Thus, for every M, there is a such that M >M M = max q,…,q. Since $E$ , one infers that for every M there is a n0 n0 1 n0 k∈ N,k<n, such that 1 > p e ∨ $e \land \dots \land e \land h\land K = q >M ()$ k 1 k− 1 k and

\lim_{k \to \infty} p(e_k | e_1 \wedge \ldots \wedge e_{k-1} \wedge h \wedge K) = 1 \quad (6)

Hence, if (5) is false, then (6). But it is reasonable to demand that a negative instance of h, e, should have non-zero probability no matter how many positive instances k h have been observed given the falsity of. Thus, Keynes (1921: 275) suggested that (6) is false: “[given that] the generalisation is false, a finite uncertainty as to its conclusion being satisfied by the next hitherto unexamined instance which satisfies its premiss.”

Or, as Russell commented referring to condition (5), “[i]t is difficult to see how this condition can fail in empirical material” (1948: 455). Keynes justified the second condition, (4), by applying the principle of limited independent variety and the principle of indifference (see sections 3.a.1, 3.a.2). According to the principle of limited independent variety, qualities are classified into a finite number of groups so that two qualities that belong in the same group have the same extension, that is, they are satisfied by the same individuals, and, in this sense, they are equivalent. More precisely, [A] is the set of all qualities that are equivalent to A B∈ [A] (∀ x)(Ax≡ Bx) h; it includes all qualities, which. Thus, generalization is A,B entailed logically by the assumption that are equivalent properties. Moreover, the principle of limited variety requires that the number of independent qualities that n are inequivalent is finite. Hence, if is the number of independent qualities, by the principle of indifference one concludes that the probability of any two properties A,B to belong in the same group is 1 /n. Since h is a logical consequence of this fact, by a well-known theorem in probability theory (see section 1.a),

$p(h\lor K)$ ≥,nisafixed counting number. n

But this is exactly what the demand for finite prior probability, condition (4), requires.

8. References and further reading

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Carnap, R., (1950). Logical Foundations of Probability. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, Ltd.

Carnap, R., (1952). The Continuum of Inductive Methods. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

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Carnap, R., (1980). “A basic system of inductive logic, II” Jeffrey, R., (ed.). Studies in Inductive Logic and Probability. Berkeley: University of California Press. pp. 2-7.

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de Finetti, B., (1972). Probability and Induction. The art of guessing. London: Wiley.

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Author Information

Stathis Psillos E-mail: psillos@phs.uoa.gr University of Athens Greece

Chrysovalantis Stergiou E-mail: cstergiou@acg.edu The American College of Greece – Deree Greece

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy