Benedict de Spinoza: Philosophy of Religion

SpinozaPhilosophers generally count Spinoza (1632-1677), along with Descartes (1596-1650) and Leibniz (1646-1716), as one of the great rationalists of the 17th century, but he was also a keen student of religion whose analysis has done much to shape the outlook of early 21st-century thinkers.  For those at home in secular liberal democracies, much seems familiar and right in Spinoza: he was suspicious of the clergy and wished to limit their power; he opposed the enforcement of orthodoxy and championed freedom of thought and expression; he affirmed scripture as a source of moral guidance but rejected it as a source of philosophical or scientific truth; and he constructed a worldview in which nature is law-governed and miracles are disallowed.  Nevertheless, although a critic of religion in its traditional forms, Spinoza did not wish to see it disappear.  In his view, genuine piety opens a path to blessedness that would otherwise be closed off to most.  Such piety consists not in strict adherence to creeds or scrupulous performance of rituals but in simple obedience to the divine law, which commands the love of God and of neighbor through the practice of justice and charity above all else. Regarding the state, Spinoza advocates a tolerant society in which an individual’s religious belief is a matter of public indifference.  It is also a society that allows individuals the freedom to philosophize without fear of being charged with impiety.

Table of Contents

  1. Spinoza’s Religious Identity
  2. The Sources for Spinoza on Religion
  3. God, Nature, and Miracles
  4. Prophecy
  5. Moses and the Law
  6. Christ
  7. The Interpretation and Aim of Scripture
  8. A Universal Faith
  9. Religion and the State
  10. References and Further Reading
    1. References
    2. Further Reading

1. Spinoza’s Religious Identity

Spinoza was born into Amsterdam’s Portuguese Jewish community a few decades after it had been constituted.  The Jews of this community were of converso stock—they came from families, long established in the Iberian Peninsula, who had converted from Judaism to Christianity.  Because their conversions were by and large coerced, these families often maintained some form of Jewish identity in their private lives while keeping up a public-facing Christianity.  In doing so, they risked social sanction and, after the establishment of the Portuguese Inquisition in 1536 (a successor to the Spanish Inquisition, established in 1478), the possibility of inquisitorial proceedings.  To escape these risks, as well as to find new economic opportunities, waves of conversos emigrated from Portugal in the 16th and 17th centuries.  Some found their way to Amsterdam.  The city offered the economic opportunities they were looking for and the chance to re-establish themselves as Jews.

As a child of Amsterdam’s Portuguese Jewish community, Spinoza received a traditional Jewish education.  As would be expected, his family sent him to the Talmud Torah school operated by the united congregation of the same name.  In the first four levels of the school, students read the prayer book, learned Hebrew, studied Torah, and worked through biblical commentary.  The fifth and sixth levels were devoted to more advanced studies, focused on Talmud, and were primarily undertaken by those boys on a path to the rabbinate.  There is little question that Spinoza completed the first four levels – likely by the age of fourteen – but controversy remains about whether and how far beyond that he went.  It may well be that, with the expectation that he would become a merchant like his father Michael, Spinoza ended his formal education after completing the fourth level to work full-time in the family’s trading business.  After his father’s death in 1654, he took over the business and entered a partnership with his younger brother Gabriel.

None of this means that Spinoza did not continue his education as a Jew.  In addition to whatever self-study he pursued, he had the opportunity to attend one or more of the informal yeshivas operating in the community.  Although not certain, there is some evidence that he attended the yeshiva Keter Torah (Crown of the Law) operated by Rabbi Saul Levi Mortera (1596-1660), a learned Talmudist from Vienna.  As Mortera was also conversant with the Jewish philosophical tradition, Spinoza may have gained exposure to Maimonides (1138-1204) and other Jewish philosophers through him.  By the mid-1650s, when he was in his early twenties, Spinoza, while not trained for the rabbinate, had a thorough grounding in the Jewish religious and intellectual tradition.

It was at this time that a dramatic rupture occurred in Spinoza’s life.  In July of 1656, the governing board of the Talmud Torah congregation subjected Spinoza, twenty-three years of age, to a herem: a religious condemnation and order of expulsion from the community.  In Spinoza’s case, the condemnation was severe, and the expulsion was permanent.  It is not known precisely what offense triggered the herem.  There is no first-hand information from this period, and Spinoza does not address the incident in his surviving correspondence.  The document itself cites his “abominable heresies” and “monstrous deeds” but gives no specifics.  It is tempting to look at Spinoza’s writings for answers – they are full of heterodox ideas that would have drawn the ire of his community – but it is impossible to know how much of what they contain was in his mind at the time of the herem.  Whatever it was that triggered the herem, it was serious enough in the minds of the community’s leaders to expel him permanently.

Among the questions the herem raises is whether and in what sense Spinoza should be considered a Jewish philosopher or even a Jew at all.  He was expelled from his community, and, if the words attributed to him by his biographer Lucas are to be believed, he was happy to go:

All the better; they do not force me to do anything that I would not have done of my own accord if I did not dread scandal; but, since they want it that way, I enter gladly on the path that is opened to me, with the consolation that my departure will be more innocent than was the exodus of the early Hebrews from Egypt. (Lucas, Life, p. 51)

Whether Spinoza continued to think of himself as a Jew after his expulsion is difficult to determine.  Although many of his friends, associates, and critics saw him as one, he did not present himself as such in his writings.  Among other things, he wrote under the Latin Benedictus rather than the Hebrew Baruch (or the Portuguese Bento).  More telling is the fact that he never sought reintegration into his community.  From the time of the herem on, he was content to live and work in a Christian social milieu, and he formed a number of intimate friendships with free-thinking Protestants, who became his most ardent supporters.  There is no evidence, however, that he converted to Christianity or came to identify as a Christian.  While he admired the religiosity of his friends, he disdained sectarian Christianity.  This included both Roman Catholicism, which he regarded as little more than organized superstition, and Reformed Calvinism, which was dominant in the Netherlands.  Thus, one may see in Spinoza an individual – so familiar in the early 21st century but so rare in his – who lived without any sense of religious identity.

2. The Sources for Spinoza on Religion

Spinoza treats religion throughout his corpus.  His magnum opus, the Ethics, published posthumously, sets forth his account of God, the outflow of all things from God, bondage to the passions, liberation from passions, and the attainment of happiness in the intellectual love of God.  His most important treatment of religion, however, is the Theological-Political Treatise, published anonymously in 1670.  The Treatise reflects much of the philosophy of the Ethics, but it does not articulate the grand philosophical vision of that work and on occasion adopts language at odds with it.  Spinoza intended it to prepare his audience for the Ethics, which he feared would be met with religiously based prejudice.

The primary aim of the Treatise is to argue on behalf of the liberty of thought and expression in general and what Spinoza calls the freedom of philosophizing in particular.  This is made clear in the full title of the work— Theological-Political Treatise: Several Discussions Showing that the Republic Can Grant Freedom of Philosophizing without Harming Its Peace or Piety and Cannot Deny It without Destroying Its Peace and Piety.

Since Spinoza sees the primary threat to the freedom of philosophizing to emanate from the enforcement of religious orthodoxy, the Treatise makes the case that genuine piety, as revealed to the prophets and communicated through scripture, consists in simple obedience to the divine law, which commands the love of God and neighbor through the practice of justice and charity above all else.  As its belief requirements are minimal, genuine piety leaves speculative inquiry largely unconstrained.  The freedom of philosophizing may thus be allowed without posing any threat to it.

In making his case, Spinoza is primarily concerned with what one might call biblical religion, encompassing Judaism, Christianity, and the precursors to those traditions among the ancient Hebrews and early followers of Jesus.  (Islam comes up for occasional discussion but gets no sustained treatment.)  Accordingly, a great deal of the Treatise is dedicated to developing an account of prophecy, revelation, miracles, the Mosaic law, the Hebrew state, Christ, and his apostles.  Perhaps of most lasting significance is Spinoza’s understanding of the biblical texts and his method of interpreting them.  It is in virtue of his contributions in this area that he is counted as one of the founders of modern biblical criticism.

3. God, Nature, and Miracles

Although Spinoza has often been accused of atheism, his account of God is foundational to his philosophical vision.  Spinoza’s God, however, is not the God of the Bible.  He is not the creator of the universe who rules over it with providential care.  He does not execute justice or show mercy, and he does not act with plans, purposes, or ends in view.  Most importantly, he is not personal in any meaningful sense of the word.  He is, as Spinoza defines him, an infinite being or, more precisely, a substance consisting of infinite attributes: “By God I understand a being absolutely infinite, that is, a substance consisting of an infinity of attributes, of which each one expresses an eternal and infinite essence” (Ethics ID6).

As God is a substance consisting of infinite attributes, his essence is maximally extensive.  Of the attributes that constitute it, two are knowable to humans.  These are the Cartesian attributes of thought and extension.  While Descartes takes these attributes to constitute the essence of mind and body respectively (see Principles 1.63), Spinoza takes them to constitute that portion of the divine essence that one can cognize.

From this definition of God, Spinoza demonstrates that God exists of necessity from his essence and is therefore self-caused.  An infinite substance, Spinoza argues, has infinite power to exist.  More importantly, he demonstrates that God is the only substance.  Spinoza does not mean by this that God is the only infinite substance, all others being finite, but that God is the only substance at all.  Other things that one might take to be substances – rocks, trees, dogs, humans, and the like – are merely modes of God, existing in God as modifications of his substance that express his attributes in some determinate way: “Particular things are nothing but affections or modes by which God’s attributes are expressed in a certain and determinate way” (Ethics, IP25, corollary).

In taking this position, Spinoza is rejecting traditional monotheism in favor of substance monism.  According to his version of this doctrine, everything that exists is either God, the infinite substance, or a mode of God.  Apart from God and his modes, there is nothing.

It is in the light of this doctrine that one can understand Spinoza’s controversial identification of God and Nature, expressed in his short formula Deus sive Natura.  Nature, as Spinoza understands it, does not exist in addition to God as a distinct order of things that God creates, governs, or directs.  It is one and the same as God.  Here, however, Spinoza makes a distinction.  Nature may be taken alternatively as the immanent, active principle from which all things arise or as the things themselves that arise from this immanent, active principle.  The former, which Spinoza calls Natura naturans (literally: Nature naturing), is identifiable with God, the one substance, whereas the latter, which he calls Natura naturata (literally: Nature natured), is identifiable with the modes of this substance.  This is important, for it means that Spinoza, although he identifies God and Nature, is not a pantheist, at least not if one takes pantheism according to its simplest formulation as the doctrine that the universe is God.  The universe, for Spinoza, is the totality of modes – Natura naturata – of which God is the active, immanent principle – Natura naturans.  Since these modes exist in God, the infinite substance, some commentators have proposed ‘panentheism’ as a more appropriate label for Spinoza’s view, although there is no consensus on this matter.

Nearly as controversial as Spinoza’s identification of God and Nature is his view that all things – all modes – follow the divine essence with strict necessity: “From the necessity of the divine nature there must follow infinitely many things in infinitely many modes (i.e., everything which can fall under an infinite intellect)” (Ethics IP16).

Although all modes follow from the divine essence of strict necessity, some of these modes – the infinite modes – do so from that essence taken absolutely, while others of these modes – the finite modes – do so from that essence taken as modified by one or more finite modifications, which is just to say that they are causally determined by other finite modes, which are causally determined by still other finite modes, and so on.  Such a view quite obviously rules out the creation of the universe by a free act of God’s will, but it also rules out contingency within the universe: “In nature there is nothing contingent, but all things have been determined from the necessity of the divine nature to exist and to produce an effect in a certain way” (Ethics IP29).

In Spinoza’s view, since all things follow with strict necessity from the divine essence, things cannot be other than how they are.  If they were, that essence would be other than it is, which is impossible. The universe as a whole and in its parts must thus be exactly as it is.

Given this view, it is not surprising that Spinoza would reject one of the central pillars on which biblical religion rests.  This is the occurrence of miracles, understood as divinely caused events that contravene the laws of nature.  Unlike Hume (1711-1776), who attacks the evidentiary basis of belief in miracles, arguing that the testimonial evidence in their favor is never such as to justify believing that one has occurred (see Enquiry, sec. 10), Spinoza attacks their very possibility.

The laws of nature, he argues, are decreed by God, but they are not arbitrary dictates of the divine will that he can suspend or revoke.  Rather, they are necessary consequences of the divine nature.  Hence, if God were to act in contravention of those laws – something he would do if he were to bring about a miracle – God would act in contravention not only of his decrees but of his nature as well.  As such action is absurd, miracles must be judged impossible:

[T]he universal laws of nature are nothing but decrees of God, which follow from the necessity and perfection of the divine nature.  Therefore, if anything were to happen in nature which was contrary to its universal laws, it would also necessarily be contrary to the divine decree, intellect, and nature.  Or if someone were to maintain that God does something contrary to the laws of nature, he would be compelled to maintain at the same time also that God acts in a way contrary to his own nature.  Nothing could be more absurd than that. (TTP 6, 154)

In Spinoza’s universe, there is no room for miracles.  Everything that happens does so in accordance with the laws of nature, which are necessary consequences of the divine nature and admit of no exceptions.

What, then, should be made of the putative miracles to which so many individuals have testified throughout history?  Spinoza answers that such “miracles” are nothing more than unusual events for which there are no explanation:

It clearly follows that the term “miracle” cannot be understood except in relation to men’s opinions, and means nothing but a work whose natural cause we cannot explain by the example of another familiar thing, or at least cannot be so explained by the one who writes or relates the miracle. (TTP 6, 155)

According to Spinoza, there are no genuine miracles in the sense of divinely caused events that contravene the laws of nature, but there are events that fall outside ordinary experience which cannot be explained by causes that are familiar.  Such events, because they excite wonder, are regarded as miracles, especially if one lacks a scientific worldview.

Notably, Spinoza argues that the authors of scripture lacked a scientific worldview, and it is this that accounts for the many reports of miracles in their narratives.  Spinoza dismisses some of these reports as interpolated fictions, but his usual practice is to interpret them naturalistically.  A case in point is his treatment of the report, given in Joshua 10:12-14, of God causing the sun to stand still in the sky during the battle of Gibeon.  Picking up on a reference to hailstones in Joshua 10:11, Spinoza speculates that, on the day of the battle, there was an unusual amount of ice in the atmosphere, which caused an increase in the refraction of sunlight, which in turn caused a lengthening of the day.  Joshua, having no understanding of astronomy, meteorology, or optics, reported this phenomenon as a miracle.  In accordance with his understanding of the world, he reported it as God causing the sun to stand still in the sky.

Thus far, Spinoza has an argument against the possibility of miracles and an account of how putative miracles are to be understood.  He adds to these the surprising claim that, even if a genuine miracle were to occur, it would be of dubious epistemic value, at least with respect to humanity’s knowledge of God.  This is because miracles, having no natural causes, surpass human understanding, and what surpasses human understanding cannot serve as the basis of understanding anything, let alone God:

But from a work, and absolutely, from anything which surpasses our power of understanding, we can understand nothing.  For whatever we understand clearly and distinctly must become known to us either through itself or through something else which through itself is understood clearly and distinctly.  So from a miracle, or a work surpassing our power of understanding, we can understand neither God’s essence, nor his existence, nor absolutely anything concerning God and nature. (TTP 6, 157)

Instead of looking to miracles for an understanding of God, Spinoza suggests looking to the operations of the universe and the laws that govern it.  As these are necessary consequences of the divine nature, they are the best way of gaining such an understanding: @

On the contrary, since we know that all things are determined and ordained by God, that nature’s operations follow from God’s essence, indeed, that the laws of nature are God’s eternal decrees and volitions, we must conclude absolutely that the better we know natural things – the more clearly we understand how they depend on their first cause, and how they produce effects according to the eternal laws of nature – the better we know God and his will. (TTP 6, 157)

As Spinoza here makes clear, it is only by increasing one’s understanding of the operations of the universe and the laws that govern it that increases one’s understanding of God.  It is also the only means of increasing one’s understanding of Nature, which is the same.  The attempt to do so through miracles is nothing but mystification.

4. Prophecy

As already noted, the concrete forms of religion with which the Theological-Political Treatise deals are Judaism, Christianity, and the precursors of those traditions among the ancient Hebrews and early followers of Jesus.  Because these forms of religion are based on claims of prophetic revelation from God, it is fitting that the first two chapters of the Treatise are devoted to prophecy in the biblical tradition.

Spinoza begins his discussion by giving an unexceptional definition of prophecy as knowledge received by humans from God: “Prophecy, or Revelation, is the certain knowledge of some matter which God has revealed to men” (TTP 1, 76).  In giving this definition, Spinoza does not wish to suggest that prophetic knowledge is in any way supernatural.  His identification of God and Nature does not allow for this.  Rather, he wishes to distinguish prophetic knowledge from knowledge derived from the natural light of reason.  He thus wishes to distinguish prophetic knowledge from philosophical knowledge, although he acknowledges that the latter depends on God as well, insofar as it requires “knowledge of God and of his eternal decrees” (TTP 1, 76).

Understanding how prophecy works, Spinoza argues, allows no recourse other than to consult scripture, which is a record of prophecy and conveys its contents to humanity.  Doing so shows that it is either auditory, that is, given through words heard by the prophet, or visionary, that is, given through appearances seen by the prophet.  Furthermore, one finds that these words and appearances are either real or imaginary:

If, then, we run through the Sacred books, we will see that everything God revealed to the Prophets was revealed to them either in words, or in visible forms, or in both words and visible forms.  The words and visible forms were either true, and outside the imagination of the Prophet who heard or saw them, or else imaginary, occurring because the imagination of the Prophet was so disposed, even while he was awake, that he clearly seemed to himself to hear words or to see something. (TTP 1, 79)

As it turns out, in virtually every case, the words and appearances experienced by the prophets were imaginary, and Spinoza lines up an impressive array of biblical passages to establish this.  One exception is the case of Moses, to whom God spoke directly with real rather than imagined words.  How this or any other form of prophetic communication was possible, Spinoza declines to speculate.  He concludes, however, that what is required of a prophet is not exceptional intellectual ability but a fertile imagination:

We have asserted, then, that… no one has received God’s revelations without the aid of the imagination, i.e., without the aid of words or images.  So, no one needed to have a more perfect mind in order to prophesy, but only a more vivid imagination. (TTP 1, 85)

In saying this, Spinoza is breaking with an important tradition in Jewish philosophy, most notably represented by Maimonides, which takes prophets to be individuals not only of great imagination but of great intellect as well (see Guide 2.36-38).  According to this tradition, the perfection of both faculties is requisite to prophecy.  An individual of great imagination who lacks similarly great intellect may possess certain divinatory powers but may not rise to the level of a prophet.  Prophets must rival or even surpass the greatest philosophers in intellectual power.  When seen against this view, Spinoza’s view is deflationary.

The implications of Spinoza’s view are enormous.  Among the most important is that, with respect to speculative matters, it is a mistake to look to the prophets for guidance.  Although they are the recipients of revelation, they have no special insight into the nature of God, the origin and structure of the cosmos, the human mind, the human body, and so on.  They do not even agree among themselves on these matters.  What the prophets received, according to Spinoza, was penetrating moral insight, but this insight was adapted to their pre-existing beliefs, which were for the most part born of ignorance:

[We have established] that God accommodated his revelations to the power of understanding and to the opinions of the Prophets, and that the Prophets could be ignorant of things which concern only speculation, but not those things which concern loving-kindness and how to conduct our lives, and that they really were ignorant and had contrary opinions [regarding speculative matters].  So we really should not seek knowledge of natural and spiritual things from them.  We conclude, therefore, that we are not bound to believe the prophets with regard to anything except what is the end and substance of revelation.  In all other things, each person is free to believe as he pleases. (TTP 2, 109)

The lesson here is that, while the prophets offer valuable moral guidance, if one wishes to gain speculative understanding, one must cultivate the intellect and discipline one’s reason rather than consult the prophets’ texts and pour over their words.  One must engage in philosophy rather than scriptural study.

5. Moses and the Law

In his treatment of prophecy, Spinoza devotes the greatest share of attention to Moses.  It has already been seen that he considers Moses to be exceptional among prophets insofar as the words through which God communicated with him were real rather than imagined.  This Spinoza takes from Numbers 12:6-8, in which God declares that, while he speaks to other prophets in dreams and visions, he speaks to Moses “mouth to mouth.”  What is most important to Spinoza about Moses, however, is that he organized the Hebrew people into a political community after leading them out of bondage in Egypt.  On Spinoza’s account, Moses did this by arrogating absolute power to himself and imposing a comprehensive set of laws governing all aspects of life and regulating all spheres of activity.  Given that the Hebrew people had just emerged from long years of slavery and had no experience of self-rule, such measures were necessary.  What is more, as Moses understood that the community would be stronger and more stable if its members were induced to obey this law willingly rather than coercively, he created a state religion in which obedience became the very expression of piety.  It is in the formation of this religion that one sees the distant origins of what would become Judaism.

Central to the system of law that Moses laid down, according to Spinoza, is the ceremonial law, which consists of regulations concerning sacrifice, festivals, feasts, purity, dress, diet, sabbath observance, prayer, circumcision, and the like.  Unlike the divine law, which is universal and conduces to moral development and the attainment of blessedness, this law has no moral valence.  It is particular to the Hebrew people and conduces only to the prosperity of their state: “[I]t is established that ceremonies contribute nothing to blessedness, and that those of the Old Testament, indeed, the whole law of Moses, were concerned with nothing but the Hebrew state, and consequently, with nothing but corporeal advantages” (TTP 5, 146).  As the ceremonial law conduces to the prosperity of the Hebrew state, Spinoza argues, it is part and parcel of the election of the Hebrew people.  That election, as Spinoza understands it, has reference to the state, its perseverance, and its flourishing.  It has no reference beyond that:

Their election, therefore, and their calling consisted only in the enduring prosperity of their state and in other [temporal advantages].  Nor do we see that God promised the Patriarchs or their successors anything more than this.  Indeed, all the Law promises for obedience is the continual prosperity of their state and the other advantages of this life.  Conversely, [it threatened] nothing for obstinacy and breaking the covenant except the ruin of their state and the greatest [temporal] disadvantages. (TTP 3, 115)

The conclusion that Spinoza draws from these observations is that the ceremonial law – or the Mosaic law more generally – is binding on those individuals living within the Hebrew state during the period in which it endured and its people were elected.  Those living after that state ceased to exist and who can make no claim to election, including the Jews of Spinoza’s day, are in no way bound by it and gain no benefit from observing it:

So there is no doubt that after their state was dissolved the Jews were no more bound by the law of Moses than they were before their social order and the Republic began.  For before the exodus from Egypt, when they lived among other nations, they had no laws peculiar to themselves, and were not bound by any law, except natural law and, no doubt, the legislation of the Republic in which they were living (insofar as it was not contrary to the divine natural law). (TTP 5, 142-143)

It is difficult to overstate the radicalness of what Spinoza is saying here.  In denying the continued validity of the Mosaic law, Spinoza is challenging the fundamental basis of Jewish life and practice as he understands it.  This does not mean that he is calling for a cessation of that life and practice, but it is unclear what rationale he sees for its continuation, and he makes no attempt to provide one.

In this context, it is interesting to note that Spinoza does credit the persistence of ceremonial observance by Jews – particularly, the practice of circumcision – for their perseverance as a diaspora people in Christian and Islamic lands.  He even entertains the possibility that they will at some future time reestablish the Hebrew state:

Indeed, if the foundations of their religion did not make their hearts unmanly, I would absolutely believe that someday, given the opportunity, they would set up their state again, and God would choose them anew.  That’s how changeable human affairs are. (TTP 3, 124)

Such an observation is not an expression of proto-Zionism.  It is rather a judgment about the character of a people and the vicissitudes of history.  Assuredly, the state that Spinoza has in mind here is not a secular state, such as the modern state of Israel, but a theocratic state based on the Mosaic law.  In such a state, that law would once again be binding, and the people would once again be elected.

6. Christ

A second figure of great interest to Spinoza is Jesus of Nazareth, whom he consistently refers to by his Christian appellation, Christ.  According to Spinoza, Christ, unlike Moses, was uninterested in statecraft.  His concern was with blessedness and the precepts of the divine law that lead to it.  Chief among these precepts is the love of God and neighbor, which manifests itself in the practice of justice and charity.  In Spinoza’s view, while Moses taught these precepts as well, he understood them as special dictates of the divine will given to the Hebrew people alone.  In contrast, Christ understood them as eternal truths applying to all people everywhere.  His apostles, having learned these precepts from him, took them outside the Jewish community and proclaimed them to every nation.  In this way, Christ became the founder of a truly catholic religion, although one that quickly lapsed into sectarianism as his teaching became mixed with theological dogma and philosophical speculation.  This movement toward sectarianism, Spinoza argues, began with the apostles themselves as they adapted Christ’s teaching to their individual understanding and preached it to diverse audiences.

Perhaps most interesting in Spinoza’s treatment of Christ is his claim that the way in which he received revelation was even more direct than the way in which Moses received it.  Finding no instance in the gospels in which God communicated with Christ through words, real or imagined, Spinoza asserts that God communicated with him “mind to mind.”  This is to say that Christ enjoyed unmediated intellectual apprehension of the precepts of the divine law, which is precisely what allowed him to understand them as eternal truths applying to all people everywhere.  Such apprehension, Spinoza claims, is something no one else, including Moses, has so far enjoyed:

[F]or a man to perceive by the mind alone things that aren’t contained in the first foundations of our knowledge, and can’t be deduced from them, his mind would necessarily have to be more excellent than, and far superior to the human mind.  So I do not believe that anyone else has reached such a perfection, surpassing all others, except Christ, to whom the decisions of God, which lead men to salvation, were revealed immediately – without words or visions.  So God revealed himself to the Apostles through Christ’s mind, as previously he had revealed himself to Moses by means of a heavenly voice.  And therefore Christ’s voice, like the one Moses heard, can be called the voice of God. (TTP 1, 84)

As Christ enjoyed unmediated intellectual apprehension of the precepts of the divine law, he is set apart from all the prophets, whose apprehension of those precepts was by way of the imagination.  His voice, Spinoza goes so far as to say, can thus be likened to the voice of God that spoke to Moses.  For this reason, he concludes, “Christ was not so much a Prophet as the mouth of God” (TTP 4, 133).

That Christ comes in for such favorable treatment as compared with Moses and other Hebrew prophets has aroused suspicion and even consternation among many of Spinoza’s readers, especially his Jewish readers.  Given that he was writing for a largely Christian audience, some see Spinoza’s comments as more strategic than sincere.  Others see them as a betrayal of his own Jewishness.  Whatever the case may be, it is important to note that Spinoza stopped well short of endorsing some of the most fundamental Christian dogmas about Christ.  In the Theological-Political Treatise, for example, he writes vaguely about “the things some of the churches maintain about Christ,” and adds, “I freely confess that I do not grasp them” (TTP 1, 84).  In a letter to Oldenburg, he is more forthcoming.  After asserting that God’s eternal wisdom is manifest most fully in Christ’s mind, he says this about the incarnation:

As to what certain Churches add to this – that God assumed a certain nature – I warned expressly that I don’t know what they mean.  Indeed, to confess the truth, they seem to me to speak no less absurdly than if someone were to say to me that a circle had assumed the nature of a square. (Ep. 73: to Oldenburg)

Finally, in a subsequent letter to Oldenburg, after acknowledging that the apostles believed that Christ physically rose from the dead, he insists that this event must nevertheless be understood in a purely spiritual and moral sense:

I conclude, then, that the resurrection of Christ from the dead was really spiritual, and was revealed only to the faithful, according to their power of understanding . . . and at the same time that he gave, by his life and death, an example of singular holiness, and to that extent he raises his disciples from the dead, insofar as they follow this example of his life and death. (Ep. 75: to Oldenburg)

From these remarks, it is clear that Spinoza, whether sincere or not in his remarks about Christ, could not sign on to anything close to Christian orthodoxy about him.

7. The Interpretation and Aim of Scripture

 Spinoza’s discussion of prophecy naturally leads to a discussion of scripture, and this discussion has scandalized readers of the Theological-Political Treatise as much as anything else.  In one sense, Spinoza considers the Bible, consisting of both the Hebrew scriptures and the New Testament, to be a thoroughly human document.  It contains diverse writings composed by diverse authors writing in different places and times for different purposes and audiences.  In many cases there is little or no information about how its books came to be, and in no cases were their originals discovered.

Perhaps because he considers the Bible to be such a thoroughly human book, Spinoza advocates a thoroughly naturalistic method of scriptural interpretation: “To sum up briefly, I say that the method of interpreting Scripture does not differ at all from the method of interpreting nature, but agrees with it completely” (TTP 7, 171).  What Spinoza means by this is deceptively simple.  Just as an understanding of Nature comes by a careful examination of Nature itself, so must arrive an understanding of scripture by a careful examination of scripture itself.  In other words, one cannot attribute anything to scripture that is not found from a close study of its words: “Therefore, the universal rule in interpreting Scripture is to attribute nothing to Scripture as its teaching which we have not understood as clearly as possible from its history” (TTP 7, 172).  In Spinoza’s view, this study involves more than a simple reading.  It involves first, a thorough study of the languages – Hebrew and Greek – in which scripture is written; second, a collection of the main pronouncements of each book organized under appropriate headings, together with a notion of obscurities and contradictions to be found among them; and third, a historical study of the authors of scripture, the circumstances under which they wrote, and the transmission and canonization of their writings.

What should be sought in all this is what Spinoza calls the true meaning of scripture, which he identifies with authorial intention or what the author wishes to convey.  This meaning, he insists, is not to be confused with the truth of fact, which may or may not align with it and which cannot be used to determine it.  For example, when one is confronted with Moses’ claim that God is fire or that God is jealous (Deut. 4:24), the fact that God is neither of these things gives no guidance as to what Moses may have meant.  Now since Moses elsewhere states that God is incorporeal (Deut. 4:15), there is reason to take the first of these claims metaphorically, provided, of course, that doing so accords with accepted linguistic usage among the Hebrews.  However, since Moses never states that God is free of affection, there is no reason to do the same with respect to the second of these claims.  So, despite the fact that God is not jealous, one cannot take Moses to have meant anything other than what he appears to have meant.  One must take the meaning of his claim at face value and adhere to the literal sense.

In saying this, Spinoza is again breaking with important figures in the Jewish (as well as the Christian) tradition.  Maimonides, whom Spinoza criticizes at length on this point, famously argues that as scripture is true in everything it teaches, all passages that appear to conflict with demonstrated truth must be interpreted in such a way as to align with that truth.  He even goes so far as to say that if Aristotle and his successors had succeeded in demonstrating the eternity of the world – something, he argues at great length, they did not succeed in doing – all passages asserting the world’s creation in time would have to undergo radical reinterpretation (see Guide 2.25).  As Spinoza points out, however, this assumes that the biblical authors had philosophical and scientific knowledge far beyond what is reasonable to suppose.  In addition, it has the consequence that, until the truth of those matters on which scripture speaks is known, one can never be sure of what it is saying about them:

[Maimonides] cannot be certain of the true meaning of Scripture, however clear it may be, so long as he can doubt whether the proposition it seems to assert is true, or so long as he thinks the truth of that proposition has not been established.  For so long as the truth of the matter is not established, we don’t know whether the thing agrees with reason or is contrary to it.  So [on this theory] we wouldn’t know whether the literal meaning is the correct interpretation or not. (TTP 7, 188)

This, Spinoza thinks, is madness.  One’s understanding of scripture must be drawn from scripture itself and not from independent considerations of what is true or false.  The true meaning of scripture cannot be derived from the truth of fact.

What, then, is found when one turns to scripture?  Spinoza’s answer is that, despite the diverse and sometimes conflicting outlooks of the biblical texts, one finds agreement over certain basic theological affirmations: that God exists; that God exercises providence over creation; that God rewards the righteous and punishes the wicked; and so on.  One also find agreement over certain basic moral affirmations: that one should uphold justice; that one should help the needy; that one should not murder; and so on.  At the core of scripture, however, is a simple command to love God and neighbor by practicing justice and charity.  It is this command, rather than any speculative doctrine, that scripture communicates first and foremost: “From Scripture itself we have perceived its most important themes without any difficulty or ambiguity: to love God above all else, and to love your neighbor as yourself” (TTP 12, 255).  According to Spinoza, scripture places so much importance on this command that it identifies obedience to it as the means of attaining blessedness.  In doing so, it opens a more democratic path to blessedness than that which is offered by philosophy.  Everyone is capable of obedience in response to a command, but few are capable of following the guidance of reason and achieving enlightened understanding.  This message of obedience, Spinoza insists, is what makes scripture so vital to human welfare.  In its absence, humanity could never know that blessedness can be achieved by this means, and its hope for it would be greatly diminished:

We can’t perceive by the natural light that simple obedience is a path to salvation.  Only revelation teaches that this happens, by a special grace of God, which we cannot grasp by reason.  It follows that Scripture has brought great comfort to morals.  Everyone, without exception, can obey.  But only a very few… acquire a habit of virtue from the guidance of reason alone.  So, if we didn’t have this testimony of Scripture, we would doubt nearly everyone’s salvation. (TTP 15, 281-282)

In short, it is by teaching that blessedness can be attained through obedience – obedience to the command to love God and neighbor by practicing justice and charity – that scripture offers hope and guidance to the mass of humans in a way that philosophy, which speaks to the few, cannot.  It is in virtue of this guidance and hope that scripture can be considered the word of God.

8. A Universal Faith

It is because he takes obedience as a means of attaining blessedness that Spinoza sees the value of faith to lie not in the truth of what it affirms but in the obedience to which it leads.  In fact, a saving faith need not be true at all.  If it leads to obedience, that is all that matters for the attainment of blessedness: “Faith requires, not so much true doctrines, as pious doctrines, i.e., doctrines that move the heart to obedience, even if many of them do not have even a shadow of the truth” (TTP 14, 267).  As a consequence of this view, Spinoza does not think that individuals should be judged faithful because their beliefs are orthodox or faithless because their beliefs are heterodox.  Such judgments should be based solely on the love of God and neighbor they do or do not exhibit.  More concretely, they should be based on the justice and charity they do or do not practice.

This view of faith quite obviously leaves broad latitude in belief, particularly concerning speculative matters that do not bear directly on action.  It thus leaves broad latitude for philosophy to go its way, unconstrained by whatever orthodoxy may prevail in society.  Even so, Spinoza thinks that there are certain doctrines one must affirm if one is to be obedient – they are, as it were, conditions of the possibility of obedience – and he defines faith in terms of them: “[Faith is] thinking such things about God that if you had no knowledge of them, obedience to God would be destroyed, whereas if you are obedient to God, you necessarily have these thoughts” (TTP 14, 266).  Spinoza enumerates seven of these doctrines, each of which enjoys consensus among the writers of scripture.  These he calls doctrines of the universal faith:

    1. God, a supreme being, exists.
    2. God is one.
    3. God is omnipresent and omniscient.
    4. God has dominion over all things.
    5. Obedience to God consists of justice and charity.
    6. Those who obey God are saved.
    7. God forgives those who repent.

It is easy to see why Spinoza would think that affirming these doctrines is necessary for obedience:  If one did not believe that God exists, one would have no reason to obey him; if one did not believe that God is one, one would not regard him as pre-eminent; if one did not believe that God is omnipresent and omniscient, one would think it possible to conceal one’s actions from him; and so on.  Each of these doctrines thus belongs to the universal faith precisely insofar as affirming it is necessary for obedience.

There are two additional things to note about these doctrines.  The first is that they are subject to a variety of interpretations according to the diversity of individual understanding.  In affirming that God exists, for example, one might believe that God is fire or light or spirit or something else altogether.  In affirming that God has dominion over all things, for another example, one might believe that God directs all things by his will or by the necessity of his nature or by some other means altogether.  Each of these doctrines is thus to a large degree philosophically indeterminate.  The only restriction is to not interpret them in a way that leads to disobedience.  The second thing to note is that these doctrines are decidedly non-sectarian.  It was Spinoza’s hope that they could be endorsed by Christians of all kinds and presumably by Jews as well.  This would not eliminate doctrinal disagreements among those groups, but it might blunt charges of impiety by one group against others on account of those disagreements.  In this way, the widespread embrace of these doctrines, together with the understanding of faith that stands behind them, might lead to greater toleration and peace within society.

9. Religion and the State

Spinoza’s views on religion are interwoven with his views on the state.  Of particular concern is the relationship between civil authority and religious authority, which is explored throughout the last five chapters of the Theological-Political Treatise.  The unfinished Political Treatise, although indispensable as a source for Spinoza’s views on the state, is less helpful on this topic.  It is focused on the most basic principles of political philosophy and is little concerned with religion.

Spinoza sees the state as emerging from an agreement among individuals to form a community and be governed by a common will.  In making this agreement, they transfer their right to live as they please to the community and ultimately to the sovereign who has charge of it.  This sovereign may be the entire people, as in a democracy; a restricted class of people, as in an aristocracy; or a single person, as in a monarchy.  Among the consequences of this transference is that the sovereign holds authority in religious as well as civil matters.  It thus falls to the sovereign to regulate such things as the performance of ceremonies, the activities of clergy, and the functioning of churches, synagogues, and other religious institutions.  More broadly, it falls to the sovereign to determine how piety is to be manifest in society, which means that the sovereign must determine what justice and charity demand of individuals.  Religious functionaries may advise the sovereign in this work, but they can have no independent authority.  To grant them such authority, Spinoza warns, is to divide sovereignty and weaken it.  It is also to invite opposition from clergy, who will use such authority to advance their interests against the sovereign.

This placement of religion under the sovereign’s authority may appear illiberal – it is directly contrary to the principle of separation of church and state – but Spinoza offers qualifications that mitigate this appearance.  Foremost among these is that the transference of rights from individuals to the sovereign is of necessity incomplete:

No one will ever be able to transfer to another his power, or consequently, his right, in such a way that he ceases to be a man.  And there can never be a supreme power who can get everything to happen just as he wishes….  So it must be granted that each person reserves to himself many things of which he remains the master, things which therefore depend on no one’s decision but his own. (TTP 17, 296)

Among the rights that individuals inevitably retain, according to Spinoza, is the right to think and express themselves as they like.  Individuals may not engage in sedition, which the sovereign can and must suppress, but they may otherwise hold and voice whatever opinions suit them.  If the sovereign seeks to deprive them of this right, it becomes tyrannical and sets itself in opposition to the very humanity of its subjects.  In so doing, it risks destabilizing itself by fostering resentment and encouraging resistance.

Importantly, Spinoza thinks that the right of individuals to think and express themselves as they like extends to religion.  Individuals can thus determine for themselves what to believe about God or any other matter of religious concern:

Therefore, since each person has the supreme right to think freely, even about Religion, and it’s inconceivable that anyone can abandon his claim to this right, each person will also have the supreme right and the supreme authority to judge freely concerning Religion, and hence to explain it and interpret it for himself” (TTP 7, 191).

In view of this, Spinoza recommends that the sovereign focus its attention on action.  Specifically, it should focus its attention on whether individuals act toward one another according to standards of justice and charity that the sovereign itself determines.  If they do, it should regard them as pious irrespective of what they believe:

[W]e conclude that nothing is safer for the republic than that piety and Religion should improve the practice of Loving-kindness and Equity, and that the right of the supreme powers concerning both sacred and secular matters should relate only to actions.  For the rest, everyone should be granted the right to think what he wants and to say what he thinks. (TTP 20, 353)

The outcome of this policy is a tolerant society in which an individual’s religious belief is a matter of public indifference.  It is also a society that allows individuals the freedom to philosophize without fear of being charged with impiety: “[T]he best republic concedes to everyone the same freedom to philosophize as we’ve shown that faith does” (TTP 20, 348).  As far as the state is concerned, what matters is how one comports oneself in one’s dealings with others.  In the final pages of the Treatise, Spinoza lauds Amsterdam as a city that to a remarkable degree embodies this toleration:

In this most flourishing republic, this most outstanding city, all men no matter what their nation or sect, live in the greatest harmony.  When they entrust their goods to someone, the only thing they care to know is whether that person is rich or poor, and whether he usually acts in good faith or not.  They don’t care at all what his religion or sect is, for that would do nothing to justify or discredit their case before a judge.  Provided they harm no one, give each person his due, and live honestly, there is absolutely no sect so hated that its followers are not protected by the public authority of the magistrates and their forces. (TTP 20, 351-352)

Spinoza may be putting these words forward more as exhortation than description.  The very text in which they were written came in for widespread condemnation, and in 1674 it was banned (together with Meijer’s Philosophy as the Interpreter of Holy Scripture and Hobbes’ Leviathan) not only in Amsterdam but throughout the Dutch Republic as well.  Nevertheless, the relative openness of Dutch society, however imperfect and fragile it may have been, was something he recognized as unique and wished to see preserved.  That such openness became taken for granted in so many early 21st-century liberal democracies is in no small measure due to his ideas.

10. References and Further Reading

a. References

  • All passages from Spinoza are quoted from the translations provided in Curley, Edwin, ed., The Collected Works of Spinoza, vols. 1 & 2 (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985 & 2016).
  • Passages from the Ethics are cited by book and definition or proposition (Ethics IP11 = Ethics, Book I, Proposition 11).
  • Passages from the Theological-Political Treatise are cited by chapter and page number as found in the second volume of Curley (TTP 7, 170 = Theological-Political Treatise, chapter 7, page 170).
  • Passages from Spinoza’s correspondence are cited by letter number and correspondent (Ep. 75: to Oldenburg = Letter 75: to Oldenburg).

b. Further Reading

  • Carlisle, Clare. Spinoza’s Religion. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2021).
  • Curley, Edwin. “Notes on a Neglected Masterpiece (I): Spinoza and the Science of Hermeneutics,” in Graeme Hunger, ed., Spinoza: The Enduring Questions. (Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1994) 64-99.
  • Donagan, Allen. “Spinoza’s Theology,” in Don Garrett, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996) 343-382.
  • Fraenkel, Carlos. Philosophical Religions from Plato to Spinoza: Reason, Religion, and Autonomy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012).
  • Fraenkel, Carlos. “Spinoza on Miracles and the Truth of the Bible.” Journal of the History of Ideas 74 (2013) 643-658.
  • Garber, Daniel. “Should Spinoza have published his philosophy,” in Charlie Huenemann, ed., Interpreting Spinoza: Critical Essays. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008) 166-187.
  • Goldstein, Rebecca. Betraying Spinoza: The Renegade Jew Who Gave Us Modernity. (New York: Schocken Books, 2006).
  • Harvey, Warren Zev. “Spinoza on Biblical Miracles.” Journal of the History of Ideas 74 (2013), 659-675.
  • Israel, Jonathan. Spinoza, Life and Legacy. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2023).
  • James, Susan. Spinoza on Philosophy, Religion, and Politics: The Theological-Political Treatise. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2012).
  • James, Susan. “Narrative as the Means to Freedom: Spinoza on the Uses of Imagination,” in Yitzhak Melamed & Michael Rosenthal, eds., Spinoza’s Theological-Political Treatise: A Critical Guide. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010) 250-267.
  • Lærke, Morgans. Spinoza and the Freedom of Philosophizing. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2021).
  • Levene, Nancy. Spinoza’s Revelation: Religion, Democracy, and Reason. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • Lucas, Jean Maximilien. The Oldest Biography of Spinoza. tr. A.J. Wolf (New York: The Dial Press, 1927).
  • Mason, Richard. The God of Spinoza: A Philosophical Study. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997).
  • Matheron, Alexandre. Le Christ et le salut des ignorants chez Spinoza. (Paris: Aubier-Montaigne, 1971).
  • Nadler, Steven. Spinoza’s Heresy: Immortality and the Jewish Mind. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001).
  • Nadler, Steven. A Book Forged in Hell: Spinoza’s Scandalous Treatise and the Birth of the Secular Age. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2011).
  • Nadler, Steven. “Scripture and Truth: A Problem in Spinoza’s Tractatus Theologico-Politicus.” Journal of the History of Ideas 74 (2013) 623-642.
  • Nadler, Steven. Spinoza: A Life. 2nd Edition. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2018).
  • Popkin, Richard. “Spinoza and Bible Scholarship,” in Don Garrett, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996) 383-407.
  • Ravven, Heidi. “Some Thoughts on What Spinoza Learned from Maimonides about the Prophetic Imagination, Part One: Maimonides and the Imagination.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 39 (2001) 193-215.
  • Ravven, Heidi. “Some Thoughts on What Spinoza Learned from Maimonides about the Prophetic Imagination, Part Two: Spinoza’s Maimonideanism.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 39 (2001) 385-406.
  • Rosenthal, Michael. “Spinoza’s Dogmas of the Universal Faith and the Problem of Religion.” Philosophy and Theology 13 (2001) 53-73.
  • Rutherford, Donald. “Spinoza’s Conception of Law: Metaphysics and Ethics,” in Yitzhak Melamed & Michael Rosenthal, eds., Spinoza’s Theological-Political Treatise: A Critical Guide. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010) 143-167.
  • Smith, Steven. Spinoza, Liberalism, and the Question of Jewish Identity. (New Haven: Yale University Press, 1997).
  • Steinberg, Justin. “Spinoza’s Curious Defense of Toleration,” in Yitzhak Melamed & Michael Rosenthal, eds., Spinoza’s Theological-Political Treatise: A Critical Guide. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010) 210-230.
  • Strauss, Leo. “How to Study Spinoza’s Theological-Political Treatise,” Proceedings of the American Academy of Jewish Research 17 (1947/48) 69-131.
  • Strauss, Leo. Spinoza’s Critique of Religion. Tr. E.M. Sinclair. (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1965)
  • Yovel, Yirmiyahu. Spinoza and Other Heretics: The Marrano of Reason. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1989).
  • Zac, Silvain. Spinoza et L’interprétation de L’Écriture. (Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1965).
  • Zac, Silvain. Philosophie, théologie, et politique dans l’œvre de Spinoza. (Paris: Vrin, 1979)

 

Author Information

Blake D. Dutton
Email: bdutton@luc.edu
Loyola University Chicago
U. S. A.