Joining the IEP Staff

Everyone working at the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy is a volunteer. We are especially looking for someone who will actively recruit authors of articles in various areas of philosophy. A recruiting editor needs a Ph.D. in philosophy. To volunteer, send an email to the general editor Brad Dowden at dowden@csus.edu.

Our volunteer positions can be filled for a short time period; you do not need to make a long-term commitment.

Area Editors

Philosophy professors are encouraged to e-mail the editor with requests to be an area editor for the IEP. Please check our list of area editors for open positions. The primary responsibilities of area editors include:

1. maintaining a list of most needed articles in the area,
2. occasionally recruiting authors for articles,
3. coordinating peer evaluation of articles submitted, and
4. making a decision about whether to publish submitted articles.

Volunteers

We are seeking volunteers for a variety of tasks at different skill levels:

• Projects Manager: Contact  delinquent authors who have promised articles and negotiate a new completion date. Ideally, this person should have a philosophy Ph.D. and a university affiliation.
• Copyeditors: The job of a copyeditor is to read through newly accepted articles and make the appropriate changes to improve them. Ideally, volunteers for this task should have a B.A. degree in some humanities discipline, such as philosophy, English, or history, and have basic copyediting skills such as a sense of good grammar, appropriate word choice, failure of an author to follow the IEP author guidelines, and so forth. [Presently, we do not need more copyeditors, but this sentence will change when we do need more volunteer copyeditors.]
• Recruiters: To help expand the number of articles and the breadth of coverage of important areas of philosophy, we seek recruiters who will seek out potential authors and request submissions. Candidate must have a Ph. D. in philosophy.
• Graphic Designer: Approximately every six months, the IEP receives an article whose line drawings need revising or whose photo needs some minor alteration. [At the moment we do not need a graphics designer.]
• Graphic Permissions Consultant: A person who is knowledgeable about what is required for the IEP to publish art and graphics that an article’s author copied from the Internet. What is required to avoid copyright infringement?
• Computer consultants: [No technical consultants are needed at the present time.]

There is no work schedule required. Volunteers work at their own pace when they have time available. Feel free to turn down a work request if you happen to be busy. To volunteer, send an email to the general editor Brad Dowden at dowden@csus.edu.

Copyeditors

• Current: Jacob Burgess, Kal Curran, S. D. Hodell, Jacob Hougie, Susan Manring, Scott Meltzer, Meah Mostafizur Rahman, Greg Stokley, Mark Weinfurter.

  Former Volunteers

History of Technical Development

• The IEP is run on WordPress, an open-source publishing platform. Josh May customized the design based on a default theme, with programming done by Alex Bundy.
• The IEP is housed on the University of Tennessee at Martin’s main web server, which is maintained by the University’s Computer Center.
• The former IEP graphics and layout program were designed by Marilynn Lawrence; the former indexing program was written by Chris Caldwell.
• Legal Consultant: Brian Butler.