The Yablo Paradox

The Yablo Paradox implies there is no way to coherently assign a truth value to any of the sentences in the countably infinite sequence of sentences, each of the form, “All of the subsequent sentences are false.” Specifically, the Yablo Paradox arises when we consider the following infinite sequence of sentences:

   

The Yablo sequence of sentences seem paradoxical in the same sense as the more well-known Liar Paradox:

   

which, when combined with the relevant instance of Tarski’s T-schema:

   

(where is result of applying any standard naming device—for example, Gödel coding—to the expression ) entails a contradiction. We can show that the Yablo sequence entails a contradiction in a similar manner via the following informal argument:

“” is the symbol for a contradictory sentence. If this were all there was to the Yablo Paradox—just another example of a semantic paradox that can be generated by sentences that predicate truth of themselves or of each other—then it would not be of much philosophical interest. But the Yablo Paradox has a number of properties not shared by its predecessors such as the venerated (or vilified?) Liar Paradox. In particular, the Yablo Paradox seems, at least at first glance, to show that semantic paradoxes do not require the sort of circularity found in the Liar Paradox (and usually taken to be a necessary condition for the presence of such paradoxes, at least until 1993).

This article carefully examines a number of aspects of the Yablo Paradox, including whether the paradox involves circularity in some disguised form, as is claimed by Graham Priest (Priest 1997) amongst others. In addition, we shall look carefully at the rather special sense in which the Yablo Paradox is paradoxical, and we shall also examine various ways that the infinitely descending structure of the Yablo Paradox can be generalized to arrive at other, at least apparently non-circular, versions of well-known paradoxes.

Table of Contents

1. Origins of the Paradox
2. Paradoxical or Not?
3. Circular or Not?
4. Generalizing the Paradox
5. References and Further Reading

1. Origins of the Paradox

The Yablo Paradox first appears in an article titled “Truth and Reflection” (Yablo 1985), where Yablo includes the following example:

Paradox Without Self-Reference: Here is an example designed to show that self-reference is not essential to paradox. For each , let be

   

so that each says that every succeeding is untrue. An intuitive argument shows that every one of these sentences is paradoxical. If were true, then given what it says, every succeeding would be untrue; but if so then every after is untrue, whence is true after all. If were untrue, then there would be an such that was true; but then by the argument just given would be both true and untrue. Once again, each is paradoxical in the sense defined above. (Yablo 1985, 340)

Yablo himself did not, at the time, attach much importance to the paradox, since it did not seem to present any new technical difficulties for the two front-running formal theories of truth at the time: Kripke’s approach sketched in “Outline of a Theory of Truth” (Kripke 1975) and the Gupta/Herzberger revision theory given in Gupta’s “Truth and Paradox” (Gupta 1982) and Herzberger’s “Notes on Naïve Semantics” (Herzberger 1982a) and “Naïve Semantics and the Liar Paradox” (Herzberger 1982b). Nevertheless, due in part to prodding by Kripke (for more on Kripke’s involvement, see (Cook 2014), Chapter 1), Yablo eventually realized that the paradox presented a serious philosophical challenge to any account (including, arguably, both the Kripke and the Gupta/Herzberger approaches) that diagnosed semantic paradoxes in terms of circularity, regardless of whether the formal apparatus built upon that philosophical account handled the Yablo construction adequately as a matter of ‘logical luck’. As a result, Yablo published a short standalone version of the paradox (Yablo 1993), and the cottage industry of work on this puzzle immediately began to boom.

Kripke’s involvement is no accident, since he raised at least the possibility of paradoxes based on non-circular, but infinitely descending structures in (Kripke 1975):

One surprise to me was the fact that the orthodox approach by no means obviously guarantees groundedness… Even if unrestricted truth definitions are in question, standard theorems easily allow us to construct a descending chain of first-order languages , , ,… such that contains a truth predicate for . I don’t know whether such a chain can engender ungrounded sentences, or even quite how to state the problem here; some substantial technical questions in this area are yet to be resolved. (Kripke 1975, 698)

Importantly, Kripke is not considering an infinitely descending sequence of sentences within a single language with a single truth predicate—that is, he is not asking about the construction at issue in the Yablo paradox proper—but is instead wondering whether similar non-circular paradoxes can be constructed within an infinitely descending sequence of Tarskian-style metalanguages, each of which contains a truth predicate for the language ‘below’ it. An affirmative answer to this distinct, but obviously intimately related question was provided by Albert Visser, independently of Yablo’s work, in “Semantics and the Liar Paradox” (Visser 2002), which was originally published in 1989 (after Yablo’s original version, but before the well-known 1993 publication of it).

Although Yablo was unaware of Kripke’s prescient comments (and of Visser’s independent work) when constructing his version of the paradox, he later characterizes the importance of the paradox in terms of its consequences for a Tarskian account of truth based on a hierarchy of metalanguages:

Are the semantic and set-theoretic paradoxes circularity-based? This has been for a long time the dominant view. It shows up in the frequently heard claims that one sure way to avoid the semantic paradoxes is to insist with Tarski on a rigid separation of object language from meta-language, and one sure way to avoid the set theoretic paradoxes is to insist with Russell on a rigid hierarchy of types.

But these claims are open to question, especially the first. Tarskian strictures may block the Liar paradox but they do not block all paradoxes of the Liar type. An example is what we can call the -Liar [the Yablo paradox]. … So the Tarskian way of avoiding paradox relies on more than a rigid object/metalanguage distinction. It is also required that the sequence of languages eventually grounds out in a bottom-level object language. (Yablo 2006, 166–167)

In short, the Yablo Paradox highlights the fact that accounts of, or solutions to, the semantic paradoxes cannot make do merely with ruling out (either philosophically or mathematically) problematic circular constructions. In addition, any such account must rule out, or at least account for, the similar puzzles that arise due to infinitely descending non-circular constructions. The standard formulation of the Tarskian account, with its insistence that a rigid object-language/metalanguage distinction eliminates semantic paradoxes, is but one of many targets, since it is susceptible to Yablo-style (better: Kripke/Visser-style) constructions unless supplemented with the requirement that the hierarchy of metalanguages is itself grounded.

This concludes our tour of the origins, and initial importance, of the Yablo Paradox. But much of this is, as is often the case in philosophy, more complicated, and more controversial than it initially appears to be. In particular, both the claim that the Yablo Paradox is genuinely non-circular, and the claim that it is a paradox in the first place (at least, in the same sense that the Liar Paradox is a paradox) can and have been challenged. In the next two sections we shall examine these claims, and we shall then, in § 4, see how to construct a truly non-circular paradox.

Before doing so, it is worth noting that we shall concentrate on Yablo’s version of the paradox, rather than on the Kripke/Visser variant, since Yablo’s version is both simpler and more well-known. All of the points made below can be reformulated so that they apply to the Kripke/Visser construction, however.

2. Paradoxical or Not?

In this section we shall examine the claim that the Yablo Paradox is, in fact, a paradox at all. One recent work on paradoxes defines paradoxes as follows:

A paradox (or apoira) is a type of argument. In particular, a paradox is an argument that:

1. Begins with premises that seem uncontroversially true.
2. Proceeds via reasoning that seems uncontroversially valid.
3. Arrives at a conclusion that is a contradiction, is false, or is otherwise absurd, inappropriate, or unacceptable.

(Cook 2012, 9–10)

Given this understanding of the nature of paradoxes, it seems like the Yablo Paradox is a paradigm instance; after all, doesn’t the argument given in the introduction of this essay amount to a proof of an absurdity (a contradiction, even) based on premises that seem uncontroversially true (or, at the very least, would seem uncontroversially true, did we not already have doubts about truth stemming from the earlier Liar paradox), and using reasoning that seems uncontroversially valid?

Well, “yes” and “no”. While that informal argument does show something, it doesn’t show that we can derive a contradiction, within standard first-order logic, from the infinite collection of sentences that are presumably meant to be the source of the paradox—the derivation given above ‘slips’ in additional resources that are worth identifying and assessing a bit more carefully.

In order to do this, we need to be a bit clearer and more explicit about both the construction of the infinite sequence of sentences that are involved in the Yablo Paradox, and about the exact details of whatever proof is supposed to provide the contradiction. Such clarity can be achieved by moving from the informal context within which the discussion has been situated to a precise construction of the paradox within first-order logic supplemented with a two-place satisfaction predicate , where is meant to hold of two numbers and if and only if is the Gödel code of a predicate “” (i.e. ) and that predicate holds of (i.e. “” is true). In short, for any predicate , we have:

   

We then obtain the Yablo Paradox by applying the binary version of Gödel’s diagonalization lemma:

Diag: For any binary relation symbol there is a unary predicate such that:

   

is a theorem of arithmetic.

to the following predicate:

   

to obtain what (Ketland 2005) calls the Uniform Fixed-Point Yablo Principle:

   

We then obtain the infinite sequence of sentences involved in the Yablo Paradox by considering the -sequence of instances of the :

   

Of course, neither the , nor the infinite sequence of its instances, is paradoxical on its own. Just as we require an instance of Tarski’s T-schema in order to obtain a contradiction from the Liar Paradox, we require some principles governing the satisfaction predicate in order to derive a contradiction here. There are two options, which amount to two ways of disambiguating the use of “” in the semi-formal principle governing “” given above. First, we can use the –Generalized Satisfaction Principle:

   

Alternatively, we could adopt, not the universally quantified formula , but rather its instances (motivated, perhaps, by the thought that the Yablo Paradox itself does not—at least in the informal formulation and proof to contradiction given above—seem to involve anything like the , but instead involves merely the infinite list of sentences that are its instances, and hence should not require the full , but should likewise require solely its instances):

   

Interestingly, in order to derive a contradiction from these ingredients, it turns out that neither the infinite list of instances of the , nor the infinite list of instances of the , is strong enough, mathematically speaking, to do the work. In order to derive a contradiction, we need the full strength of the universally quantified and . First, the following derivation shows how to obtain a contradiction from the and :

Thus, we can prove a contradiction from the and the . But the following results (with we shall not prove here) show that we cannot replace either of these principles with the infinite list of their instances:

Theorem 2.1. , plus the infinite list of instances of , is consistent.

Proof: See (Ketland 2005) for the proof, and (Ketland 2004) and (Cook 2014) for further discussion.

Theorem 2.2. , plus the infinite list of instances of , is consistent.

Proof: See (Ketland 2005) for the proof, and (Ketland 2004) and (Cook 2014) for further discussion.

[A bit more detail for the cognoscenti: Both of these results are consequences, loosely speaking, of the compactness theorem for first-order logic. Neither collection of sentences is satisfiable on the ‘standard’ model, but in both cases we can construct a non-standard model of arithmetic satisfying the principles in question, which (by the soundness theorem) suffices for consistency, and also shows that both infinite collections of formulas, while consistent, are -inconsistent. For a further discussion of the philosophical relevance of -inconsistency to semantic paradoxes in general and to the Yablo Paradox in particular, the reader is encouraged to consult (Barrio 2010), and for an insightful discussion of the Yablo Paradox in second-order arithmetic, which has no non-standard models, the reader should consult (Picollo 2013).]

The second theorem is of particular interest in the present context, since it tells us that, even in the presence of the relatively strong , we cannot prove a contradiction from the infinite sequence of sentences involved in the Yablo Paradox—at least, we cannot do so within first-order arithmetic supplemented with our binary satisfaction predicate “”. But, we might ask, what prevents us from doing so? In particular, what prevents the somewhat more informal derivation given in the introduction from being carried out within first-order arithmetic?

The answer, once one knows to look for it, is not difficult to spot. To save the reader inconvenient scrolling, let’s first reproduce the informal proof here:

The offending inference—offending in the sense that it is not valid in first-order arithmetic—is the move from line 7 to line 8. What lines 1–6 of the proof show (if regimented into precise first-order notation) is that, for any standard natural number , we can prove that is false. We cannot move from this—a proof of each instance of the sequence:

   

to the desired conclusion:

   

without knowing that the standard natural numbers are, in fact, all of the natural numbers. One way of achieving such additional deductive power via adding the following infinitary -rule to first-order arithmetic: -R: For any predicate , if we can prove:

   

then we can conclude:

   

Adding this rule to first-order arithmetic results in a much stronger (and in fact complete) system of arithmetic, however, and thus far outstrips the resources of standard first-order logic and first-order arithmetic.

In short, the reasoning used in the informal derivation of a contradiction presupposes that we are reasoning unambiguously about the standard, intended model of arithmetic (something ruled out by the Löwenheim-Skolem theorem in first-order contexts). As a result, we now have a better understanding of what, exactly, is involved in the Yablo Paradox, at least if the paradox is a genuine paradox in the sense of the term used in the passage from (Cook 2012) cited above. Either (i) the paradox involves, not merely the infinite sequence of sentences as originally supposed, but the universal generalization that provides this sequence as its instances—that is, the —plus the similarly generalized (rather than merely its instances), or (ii) the paradox involves deductive resources beyond those found in standard first-order arithmetic (even though each of the infinite sequence of sentences involved in the paradox is formulable in the standard language of first-order arithmetic, supplemented with a binary satisfaction predicate. Either way, the infinitary nature of the Yablo Paradox involves notions that go beyond what is required for its finitary, circular cousins such as the Liar Paradox.

3. Circular or Not?

Our next task is to examine the claim that the Yablo paradox is, in fact, a genuinely non-circular paradox, and thus provides a new species of paradox distinct from paradoxes involving circularity in an essential way, such as the Liar paradox. Although the informal discussion of the Yablo paradox seems to make its non-circularity evident—after all, each sentence only ‘says’ something about sentences below it in the list—we have already seen evidence that a merely informal treatment of the paradox in question can be misleading (for example, in terms of exactly what is required to generate a contradiction). Thus, it is worth examining the claim that the Yablo paradox is genuinely non-circular in a bit more detail as well.

Almost immediately after the well known (Yablo 1993) version of the Yablo paradox appeared in print, Graham Priest formulated an objection to Yablo’s claim that the paradox is, in fact, non-circular. The critical passage is this:

… the paradox concerns a predicate of the form:

   

and the fact that

= ‘’

shows that we have a fixed point, here, of exactly the same self-referential kind as in the liar paradox. In a nutshell, is the predicate ‘no number greater than satisfies this predicate’. The circularity is now manifest. (Priest 1997, 238, notation changed to match that here)

But is the circularity manifest in the manner suggested by Priest? In order to answer this question, we need to first be a bit clearer about what we mean by circularity in the first place. To begin with, consider the Liar sentence as formulated in arithmetic, which no one doubts is a paradigm instance of the sort of circularity at issue. We obtain the Liar by applying the unary version of the Gödelian diagonalization lemma:

Diag: For any unary predicate there is a sentence such that: is a theorem of arithmetic.

to the following predicate: (i.e. the negation of the truth predicate) to obtain a sentence that is equivalent to the claim that the truth predicate fails to apply to (the Gödel code of) that sentence: How, exactly, should we understand the circularity found in the Liar sentence? The answer is that the Liar sentence is a fixed point of a predicate within arithmetic in the following sense:

A sentence is a weak sentential fixed point of a unary predicate within a theory if and only if: is a theorem of .

(The qualifier ‘weak’ is retained from (Cook 2006), where this notion of sentential fixed point is contrasted with a ‘strong’ notion. I do not explore this stronger notion here, however. Similar comments apply to the definition of weak predicate fixed point below.) This sort of analysis of circularity—in terms of the existence of linguistic fixed points—was first explored independently in (Leitgeb 2002) and (Cook 2006). Clearly, the Liar sentence is a sentential fixed point of the predicate “” within arithmetic supplemented with a truth predicate, and this seems like an adequate diagnosis of the sense in which the Liar sentence is circular. Further, we can formulate an analogous notion of fixed points for predicates as follows:

A unary predicate is a weak predicate fixed point of a binary predicate within a theory if and only if:

   

is a theorem of .

We can now understand Priest’s point as nothing more than the observation that, within arithmetic supplemented with a binary satisfaction predicate, the ‘Yablo’ predicate “” is a predicate fixed point of the binary predicate:

   

In fact, the amounts, in the end, to little more than a report of this fact (and recall that the is provable using the diagonalization lemma—that is, pure arithmetic—alone, and does not require the T-schema, the , or any other non-arithmetic resources for its proof).

There seems to be little point in arguing with Priest about whether this amounts to a genuine form of circularity (since squabbling about what ‘really’ counts as circular or not threatens to obscure the real issue—understanding the roots of paradox in the first place), or whether the Yablo paradox truly ‘suffers’ from this sort of circularity (since it is a mathematical fact that it does). But there are two observations that we can make.

First, Priest’s observations regarding the circularity of the Yablo paradox are part of a larger argument that all paradoxes involve circularity (or something like it—satisfaction of his inclosure schema, see (Priest 1995)) in an essential way. The problem, however, is that sentential and predicate fixed points seem too prevalent to do much explanatory work. As noted in (Leitgeb 2002), (Cook 2006), it is easy to prove that every sentence in arithmetic (and in any theory at least as strong as arithmetic) is a weak sentential fixed point of some predicate, and every unary predicate is a weak predicate fixed point of some binary predicate.

Obtaining the result for predicate fixed points is straightforward (the analogous result for sentential fixed points is similar, simpler, and left to the reader). Given a unary predicate , let be any arbitrary predicate, and apply the binary version of the Gödelian diagonalization lemma to:

   

otaining a unary predicate such that:

   

is a theorem. The above formula is equivalent to:

   

Thus, is a weak predicate fixed point of:

   

As a result, although Priest’s claim that the Yablo paradox is circular, since it involves a predicate fixed point, is no doubt correct, it is not clear how useful the observation turns out to be in the end. If every predicate whatsoever in arithmetic (or in any theory at least as strong as arithmetic) is also a predicate fixed point, but the vast majority of such predicates do no give rise to paradoxes, then we are left wondering what special explanatory role this sort of circularity is meant to play in our account of the Yablo paradox.

Of course, the existence of fixed points is not necessarily the only way to understand or identify the presence of circularity. For example, (Leitgeb 2002) and (Yablo 2006) explore an analysis of circular linguistic constructions in terms of the structure of corresponding non-well-founded sets (although see (Cook 2014) for a series of criticisms of the viability of any such account).

Second, although Priest is right that the version of the Yablo paradox that can be constructed within arithmetic supplemented with a binary satisfaction predicate is circular in at least some minimal sense, since it explicitly involves a weak predicate fixed point, there are other ways to construct the paradox that do not seem to involve fixed points of this sort. One such method, developed in (Cook 2006) (and explored further in (Cook 2014)), involves utilizing infinitary conjunction, rather than arithmetic diagonalization, in the construction of the paradox. To construct this version of the paradox, we need a propositional language that contains (at a minimum) a countable infinity of sentence names:

   

a falsity predicate “”, and (countably) infinitary conjunction (). We can then construct a version of the Yablo paradox stipulating that each sentence name denotes the infinite conjunction of attributions of falsity to each sentence name with higher (finite) index or, a bit more intuitively:

   

This version of the Yablo paradox contains no fixed points of any sort. (See (Cook 2014) for a proof of this fact, as well as for the development of an infinitary propositional logic within which the derivation to a contradiction can be carried out. Both (Hardy 1995) and (Forster 2004) contain earlier explorations of infinitary, non-arithmetic versions of the paradox). Since the important point, of course, is not whether the exact construction Yablo had in mind is circular or not, but rather whether Yablo’s work points in the direction of a truly non-circular paradox, this construction seems to provide good evidence for the claim that there are, in fact, non-circular paradoxes.

A final note, however: In constructing the infinitary conjunction version of the Yablo paradox, we have made a trade-off. In working somewhere other than in formal arithmetic, we have avoided the need to invoke diagonalization, and have as a result blocked Priest’s argument based on the existence of weak fixed points. In order to carry this out successfully, however, we have had to introduce additional, rather substantial resources: infinitary connectives (in particular, infinitary conjunctions, and rules of inference governing such infinitary linguistic expressions). Thus, this version of the paradox is only compelling as an example of a genuinely non-circular paradox insofar as infinitary resources such as infinite conjunctions are legitimate in the first place. Unsurprisingly, perhaps, Priest preemptively objects to exactly this sort of construction:

One might suggest the following. We leave the deduction as just laid out, but construe the in the reductio part of the argument as schematic, standing for any natural number. This gives us an infinity of proofs, one of , for each . We may then obtain the conclusion by an application of the -rule:

   

The rest of the argument is as before. Construing the argument in this way, we do not have to talk of satisfaction. There is no predicate involved, a fortiori no fixed point predicate. We therefore have a paradox without circularity. (Priest 1997, 238–239)

Although Priest is describing a version of the paradox formulated in terms of an arithmetic -rule, rather than in terms of infinitary conjunction, it is clear that his objections are intended to generalize to the case at hand:

As a matter of fact, we did not apply the -rule [in his earlier sketch of the derivation of a contradiction], and could not have. The reason we know that is provable for all is that we have a uniform proof, i.e. a proof for variable . Moreover, no finite reasoner ever really applies the -rule. The only way that they can know there is such a proof of each is because they have a uniform method of constructing such proofs. And it is this finite information that grounds the conclusion . (Priest 1997, 239)

In short, Priest’s claim is that we do not, and in fact cannot, proceed via the infinitary methods in question (whether -rule or infinitary conjunction): instead, any construction of the paradox and proof of its paradoxically must rely on a uniform finitary method of construction and proof.

We will not attempt to settle this issue here (although the reader is encouraged to consult the discussion of this point in (Cook 2014)). Instead, we will conclude this section by noting that Priest’s claims about the impossibility of actually applying such infinitary reasoning strategies are controversial at best. Whether or not finite human beings (or other reasoners to which we wish our logical and semantic theories to apply) can carry out the sort of countably infinite supertasks required to construct the version of the paradox involving infinite conjunctions remains an open, and controversial, question.

4. Generalizing the Paradox

Once we have one instance of a non-circular paradox in hand, a natural question to ask is whether, and how, the basic idea underlying the Yablo paradox can be generalized. In other words, can we construct (apparently) non-circular variants of other paradoxes, and types of paradox? The answer, of course, is “yes”! We shall not attempt to produce a catalogue of all such generalizations here, however—instead, a handful of particularly interesting examples will be examined.

One of the earliest, and most well-known, variants of the Yablo paradox is Sorensen’s queue paradox. Sorensen provides a rather novel, and entertaining, presentation of this ‘dual’ version of the paradox:

An infinite queue of students receives a lecture on human fallibility. Each student thinks

(Q) Some of the students behind me are now thinking an untruth.

As it happens, each student is thinking just one thought: (Q). Of course, their different positions in the queue ensures that each token of (Q) expresses something different. (Sorensen 1998, 137)

We can formulate a version of this paradox more along the lines of the traditional presentation of the Yablo paradox by noting that each person in the queue is, in essence, thinking that at least one of the thoughts ‘behind’ her is false, obtaining:

   

This dual version of the Yablo paradox is paradoxical in exactly the same sense as the original version (careful construction of the paradox within arithmetic, and derivation of the contradiction from the dual versions of and are left to the reader).

Sorensen’s construction of this dual version of the Yablo paradox opened up two areas of research. The first was the discovery of other patterns of reference that produced paradoxes, including ‘dual’ versions of many familiar semantic paradoxes. For example, (Cook 2002) and (Cook 2004) show that, for a wide class of sentences and sets of sentences, if we replace all conjunctions with disjunctions (and vice versa) and replace all universal quantifiers with existential quantifiers (and vice versa), then the construction that results will be paradoxical if and only if the original sentence or set of sentences was. In short, the connection between Yablo’s paradox and Sorensen’s dual version is just one instance of a much wider phenomenon. The techniques and tools of directed graph theory have been invaluable in the study these patterns of paradox (for details, see (Cook 2002), (Cook 2004), (Rabern, Rabern, & Macauley 2013), and (Cook 2014)).

More important for our purposes, perhaps, is the fact that that Sorensen’s queue paradox, as well as the catalogue of other variants of the Yablo construction he produced or collected, and catalogued, in (Sorensen 1998) led to important results connecting finitary paradoxes such as the Liar paradox and infinitary, Yabloesque constructions. Sorensen characterizes the search for general methods for transforming finitary, circular paradoxes into non-circular Yabloquesque analogues as follows:

There is a wide family of paradoxes that are loosely characterized as self-referential. The simplicity of Yablo’s technique invites the conjecture that all of these paradoxes can be purged of self-reference. The conjecture could be demonstrated if there were a standard formalization of the self-referential puzzles. For one could then formulate an algorithm that mechanically transforms self-referential puzzles into Yabloesque versions. Unfortunately, there is no standard formalization. (Sorensen 1998, 150)

The most important attempts to formulate such a standard, mechanical transformation of this sort are known as unwinding theorems: results which associate with any circular paradox a corresponding non-circular analogue of it—its unwinding—such that the infinitary, non-circular Yabloesque unwinding is paradoxical if and only if the original circular construction is paradoxical. The first unwinding theorems were proven in (Cook 2002) and (Cook 2004), and applied to a propositional language containing infinitary conjunction and a falsity predicate similar to the language within which we constructed the infinitary conjunction version of the Liar paradox in the previous section. Soon after, Philippe Schlenker produced a number of unwinding recipes for arithmetic supplemented with a truth predicate (see (Schlenker 2007a), (Schlenker 2007b)). These results are complex, but a few examples should suffice to get the basic idea across.

On the simplest unwinding recipe given in (Cook 2004), the unwinding of the Liar sentence is just the Yablo paradox. The unwinding of the open pair—that is, the pair of sentences where each sentence asserts the falsity of the other:

   

is the 2-Yablo chain: an infinite sequence of sentences where each sentence asserts the falsity of every other sentence (starting with the sentence immediately after the sentence in question):

   

and the unwinding of the Liar ‘triple’:

   

is the 3-Yablo chain: an infinite sequence of sentences where each sentence asserts the falsity of every third sentence (starting with the sentence immediately after the sentence in question):

   

Note that the open pair has two acceptable truth-value assignments (either is true and is false or is false and is true) as does the 2-Yablo chain (either the even indexed sentences are true and the odd indexed sentences are false, or the even indexed sentences are false and the odd indexed sentences are true), while both the Liar ‘triple’ and its unwinding, the 3-Yablo chain, are paradoxical.

Unwinding theorems show that we can, in many cases at least, transform a finite, circular construction (whether paradoxical or not) into an infinitely descending, Yabloesque construction with many of the same properties as the original, finite construction. Unfortunately, however, such constructions don’t always deliver what we might take to be the most important desideratum of such constructions: transforming a finite, circular construction into an infinitely descending, non-circular Yabloesque construction. For example, let “Bew(x)” be Gödel’s provability predicate, and consider the Henkin sentence obtained by diagonalizing on the provability predicate:

   

Sentence ‘says’ (in effect) that it is provable. If we apply the simplest unwinding recipe found in (Schlenker 2007a), (Schlenker 2007b) to the Henkin sentence, we obtain the Uniform Fixed Point Principle for “”:

   

which has the following infinite, Yabloesque sequence of sentences as its instances:

   

Intuitively, each of these sentences (which can be constructed within first-order Peano arithmetic, since the provability predicate “” is definable in arithmetic), ‘says’ that all of the sentences ‘below’ it in the list can be proven in Peano arithmetic.

Unfortunately for anyone hoping that unwinding recipes will always provide a non-circular analogue of the original circular construction with which we started (in the sense of replacing weak sentential fixed points with weak predicate fixed points, at the very least), every sentence in the unwinding of the Henkin sentence is still a weak sentential fixed point of the provability predicate “”, as is shown by the following derivation. (The discussion here follows (Cook 2014). similar constructions can also be found in (Cieslinski & Urbaniak 2013) and (Leach-Krouse 2014)):

(Note: This derivation relies on (i) the fact that the provability predicate satisfies a version of the converse Barcan formula (lines 2–3), and (ii) Löb’s theorem (lines 5–6).) Despite this limitation, there remains much of interest, and much yet left to be discovered, in the study of unwindings.

One final generalization of the Yablo paradox is worth mentioning. Recent work on the semantic paradoxes has highlighted the fact that the Curry paradox (and the difficulties with accounting for the material conditional that come with it) is as important—perhaps more important!—than the Liar paradox. The Curry paradox (Curry 1942), which like many other constructions discussed in this chapter, can be constructed via diagonalization, is just a sentence that is equivalent to the claim that, if the sentence in question is true, then some other unrelated sentence is true. Actually, the Curry paradox is an infinite collection of intimately related paradoxes—one for each sentence. Thus, given any sentence , consider:

   

Note that the Curry sentence, like the Liar sentence, involves a weak predicate fixed point. Given (the mere existence, not the truth of) such a sentence , and the relevant instance of the T-schema, we can now prove :

What does this have to do with the Yablo paradox? One way to see the connection is as follows: we can treat negation as defined in terms of the conditional and a primitive absurdity constant “”:

   

Given this definition, the Liar paradox: is just the instance of the Curry paradox obtained by substituting the absurdity constant “” for :

   

Given all of this, it is now apparent that we have (at least) two dimensions that we can vary when considering semantic paradoxes. On the one hand, we can contrast paradoxes that involve negation or falsity (such as the Liar paradox and the Yablo paradox) with paradoxes that involve the conditional (such as the Curry paradox). On the other hand, we can contrast paradoxes that involve weak sentential fixed points (such as both the Liar and Curry) with paradoxes that involve weak predicate fixed points and infinitely descending sequences of sentences (such as the Yablo paradox. As the following chart makes clear, however, on this way of characterizing things, there is a possibility we have not yet explored:

	Negation	Conditional
Sentential Fixed Point (Finite)	Liar Paradox	Curry Paradox
Predicate Fixed Point (Infinite)	Yablo Paradox	???

In short, we have not seen a paradox that involves the conditional, rather than negation, and which also involves the sort of infinitely descending, apparently non-circular construction found in the Yablo paradox. In short, what we want is a Curry-Yablo hybrid, which we shall (following (Cook 2014) call the Yablurry paradox.

Intuitively, it is rather obvious how to to construct such a hybrid. Generalizing the insights found in the discussion of unwindings above, and given an arbitrary sentence , we want each sentence in such a Curry-Yablo hybrid to ‘say’ that the sentences below it entail . There is an ambiguity here, however. We can either have each sentence ‘say’ that, for each sentence below it in the list, if that sentence is true then , or we can have each sentence ‘say’ that, if all the sentences below it are true, then . The first option, first formulated in (Cook 2009a), provides the Yablurry paradox:

   

and the second option, which was first formulated in (Beall 1999), gives us the Dual Yablurry paradox:

   

The reasons for calling the first formulation the Yablurry paradox, and the second its Dual, are straightforward. Just as we obtain the Liar sentence when we substitute the absurdity constant for in the Curry paradox (and understand negation to be defined in terms of the conditional and absurdity), we should expect the instance of the Yablurry paradox obtained by replacing with “” to be (or be equivalent to) the Yablo paradox. And this is exactly the result we obtain. Each sentence in the Yablurry paradox is of the following form:

   

If we replace with , we obtain:

   

which then, applying our definition of negation, becomes:

   

This is exactly what we would expect of a Curry-Yablo hybrid—given the substitution of “” for , each sentence in the resulting construction ‘says’ that all sentences below it in the list are false (i.e. fail to be true).

If we carry out the same substitution in the Dual Yablurry, however, we do not obtain the Yablo paradox. Each sentence in the Dual Yablurry is of the following form:

   

Replacing with “”, we obtain:

   

Applying the definition of negation in terms of the conditional and “”, we get:

   

Which is logically equivalent to:

   

In other words, the result of substituting “” in for in this construction is Sorensen’s dual version of the Yablo paradox—hence the terminology Dual Yablurry paradox.

There are, of course, many other generalizations or modifications of the basic Yablo pattern in the literature, and many more variants no doubt yet to be discovered. Hopefully, however, the examples above give the reader some idea of the philosophical and mathematical richness of the Yablo paradox and the puzzles and problems connected to it. There remains, of course, much work to be done.

5. References and Further Reading

• Barrio, E. (2010), “Theories of Truth without Standard Models and Yablo’s Sequences”, Studia Logica  96: 377-393.
• Beall, J. (1999), “Completing Sorensen’s Menu: A Non-modal Yabloesque Curry Paradox”, Mind 108: 737-739.
• Beall, J. (2001), “Is Yablo’s Paradox Non-Circular?”, Analysis 61: 176-187.
• Beall, J. (ed.) (2003), Liars and Heaps, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Beall, J. (ed.) (2008a), Revenge of the Liar: New Essays on the Paradox, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
• Bolander, T, V. Hendricks, & S. Pedersen (2006), Self-reference, Stanford: CSLI Lecture Notes. 18
• Cieslinski, C. & R. Urbaniak (2013),”Gödelizing the Yablo Sequence”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 42: 679-695.
• Childers, T. & O. Majer (eds.), (2002), The Logica Yearbook 2002, Prague: Filosophia Press.
• Cook, R. (2002), “Patterns of Paradox: Paradox and Parity”, in Childers and Majer (2002): 69-83.
• Cook, R. (2004), “Patterns of Paradox”, Journal of Symbolic Logic 69: 767-774.
• Cook, R. (2006), “There are Non-Circular Paradoxes (but Yablo’s Isn’t One of Them!)”, The Monist 89: 118-149.
• Cook, R. (2009a), “Curry, Yablo, and Duality”, Analysis 69: 506-514.
• Cook, R. (2012), Key Concepts in Philosophy: Paradoxes, Polity Press.
• Cook, R. (2014), The Yablo Paradox: An Essay on Circularity, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Curry, H. (1942), “The Inconsistency of Certain Formal Logics”, Journal of Symbolic Logic 7: 155-117.
• Forster, T. (2004), “The Significance of Yablo’s Paradox without Self-reference”, Logique et Analyse 47: 461-462.
• Gabbay, D. & F. Guenthner (eds.) (2002), The Handbook of Philosophical Logic, Volume 11, Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic.
• Gödel, K. (1931), On Formally Undecidable Propositions of Principia Mathematica and Related Systems, New York: Dover.
• Gupta, A. (1982), “Truth and Paradox”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 11: 1-60.
• Hardy, J. (1995), “Is Yablo’s Paradox Liar-like?” Analysis 55: 197-198.
• Herzberger, H. (1982a), “Notes on Naïve Semantics”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 11: 61-102.
• Herzberger, H. (1982b), “Naïve Semantics and the Liar Paradox”, Journal of Philosophy 79: 497.
• Ketland, J. (2004), “Bueno & Colyvan on Yablo’s Paradox”, Analysis 64: 165-172.
• Ketland, J. (2005), “Yablo’s Paradox and ω-Inconsistency”, Synthese 145: 295-302.
• Kripke, S. (1975), “Outline of a Theory of Truth”, Journal of Philosophy 72: 690-716.
• Leach-Krouse, G. (2014), “Yablifying the Rosser Sentence”, The Journal of Philosophical Logic 43(5): 827-834.
• Leitgeb, H. (2002), “What is a Self-Referential Sentence? Critical Remarks on the Alleged (Non)-Circularity of Yablo’s Paradox”, Logique et Analyse 177: 3-14.
• Picollo, L. (2013), “Yablo’s Paradox in Second-Order Languages: Consistency and Unsatisfability”,Studia Logica 101: 601-613.
• Priest, G. (1995), Beyond the Limits of Thought, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Priest, G. (1997), “Yablo’s Paradox”, Analysis 57: 236-242.
• Rabern, L., B. Rabern, & M. Macauley (2013), “Dangerous Reference Graphs and Semantic Paradoxes”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 5: 727-765.
• Schlenker, P. (2007a), “The Elimination of Self-Reference: Generalized Yablo Series and the Theory of Truth”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 36: 251-307.
• Schlenker, P. (2007b), “How to Eliminate Self-Reference: A Precis”, Synthese 158: 127-138.
• Sorensen, R. (1998), “Yablo’s Paradox and Kindred Infinite Liars”, Mind 107: 137-155.19
• Visser, A. (2002), “Semantics and the Liar Paradox”, in Gabbay and Guenthner (2002): 149-240.
• Yablo, S. (1985), “Truth and Reflection”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 14: 297-349.
• Yablo, S. (1993), “Paradox without Self-Reference”, Analysis 53: 251-252.
• Yablo, S. (2006), “Circularity and Paradox”, in Bolander, Hendricks, & Pedersen (2006): 165-183.

 

Author Information

Roy Cook
Email: roycookparadox@gmail.com
University of Minnesota
U. S. A.