Epistemic Circularity

An epistemically circular argument defends the reliability of a source of belief by relying on premises that are themselves based on the source. It is a widely shared intuition that there is something wrong with epistemically circular arguments.

William Alston, who first used the term in this sense, argues plausibly that there is no way to know or to be justified in believing that our basic sources of belief–such as perception, introspection, intuitive reason, memory and reasoning–are reliable except by using such epistemically circular arguments. And many contemporary accounts of knowledge and justification allow our gaining knowledge and justified beliefs by relying on such arguments. Indeed, any account that accepts that a belief source can deliver knowledge (or justified beliefs) prior to one’s knowing (or believing justifiably) that the source is reliable allows this. It allows our knowing the premises of an epistemically circular argument without already knowing the conclusion, and using the argument for attaining knowledge of the conclusion. Still, we have the intuition that any such account makes knowledge too easy.

In order to avoid too easy knowledge via epistemic circularity, we need to assume that a source can yield knowledge only if we first know that it is reliable. However, this assumption leads to the ancient problem of the criterion and the danger of landing in radical skepticism. Skepticism could be avoided if our knowledge about reliability were basic or noninferential. It could also be avoided if we had some sort of “non-evidential” entitlement to taking our sources to be reliable. Both options are problematic.

One might think that we have to allow easy knowledge and some epistemic circularity because it is the only way to avoid skepticism. If we do so, however, we still need to explain what is then wrong with other epistemically circular arguments. One possible explanation is that they fail to be dialectically effective. You cannot rationally convince someone who doubts the conclusion of the epistemically circular argument, because such a person also doubts the premises. Another possible explanation is that such arguments fail to defeat a reliability defeater: if you have a reason to believe that one of your sources of belief is unreliable, you have a defeater for all beliefs based on the source. You cannot defeat this defeater and regain justification for these beliefs by means of epistemically circular arguments. Yet, there are still disturbing cases in which you do not doubt the reliability of a source; you are just ignorant of it. The present account allows your gaining knowledge about the reliability of the source too easily.

Thus there seems to be no completely satisfactory solution to the problem of epistemic circularity. This suggests that the ancient problem of the criterion is a genuine skeptical paradox.

Alston on Epistemic Circularity
Epistemic Failure
Easy Knowledge and the KR Principle
Coherence and Reflective Knowledge
The Problem of the Criterion
Basic Reliability Knowledge
Wittgenstein, Entitlement and Practical Rationality
Sensitivity
Dialectical Ineffectiveness and the Inability to Defeat Defeaters
Epistemology and Dialectic
References and Further Reading

1. Alston on Epistemic Circularity

When Descartes tried to show that clear and distinct perceptions are true by relying on premises that are themselves based on clear and distinct perceptions, he was quickly made aware that there was something viciously circular in his attempt. It seems that we cannot use reason to show that reason is reliable. Thomas Reid [1710-1796] (1983, 276) pointed out that such an attempt would be as ridiculous as trying to determine a man’s honesty by asking the man himself whether he was honest or not. Such a procedure is completely useless. Whether he were honest or not, he would of course say that he was. All attempts to show that any of our sources of belief is reliable by trusting its own verdict of its reliability would be similarly useless.

The most detailed characterization of this sort of circularity in recent literature is given by William Alston (1989; 1991; 1993), who calls it “epistemic circularity.” He argues that there is no way to show that any of our basic sources of belief–such as perception, intuitive reason, introspection, memory or reasoning–is reliable without falling into epistemic circularity: there is no way to show that such a source is reliable without relying at some point or another on premises that are themselves derived from that source. Thus we cannot have any noncircular reasons for supposing that the sources on which we base our beliefs are reliable. What kind of circularity is this?

Alston (1989; 1993, 12-15) takes sense perception as an example. If we wish to show that sense perception is reliable, the simplest and most fundamental way is to use a track-record argument. We collect a suitable sample of beliefs that are based on sense perception and take the proportion of truths in the sample as an estimation of the reliability of that source of belief. We rely on the following inductive argument:

At t₁, S₁ formed the perceptual belief that p₁, and p₁ is true.

At t₂, S₂ formed the perceptual belief that p₂, and p₂ is true.

.
.
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At t_n, S_n formed the perceptual belief that p_n, and p_n is true.

Therefore, sense perception is a reliable source of belief.

How are we to determine whether the particular perceptual beliefs mentioned in the premises are true? The only way seems to be to form further perceptual beliefs. Thus the premises of the track-record argument for the reliability of sense perception are themselves based on sense perception. The kind of circularity involved in this argument is not logical circularity because the conclusion that sense perception is reliable is not used as one of the premises. Nevertheless, we cannot consider ourselves justified in accepting the premises unless we assume that sense perception is reliable. Since this kind of circularity involves commitment to the conclusion as a presupposition of our supposing ourselves to be justified in accepting the premises, Alston calls it epistemic circularity.

Epistemic circularity is thus not a feature of the argument as such. It relates to our attempt to use the argument to justify the conclusion or to arrive at a justified belief by reasoning from the premises to the conclusion. In order to succeed, such attempts require that we be justified in accepting the premises. According to Alston, we cannot suppose ourselves to be justified in holding the premises unless we somehow assume the conclusion. He explains our commitment to the conclusion dialectically: “If one were to challenge our premises and continue the challenge long enough, we would eventually be driven to appeal to the reliability of sense perception in defending our right to those premises.¨ (1993, 15)

Surprisingly, Alston (1989; 1993, 16) argues that epistemic circularity does not prevent our using an epistemically circular argument to show that sense perception is reliable or to justify the claim that it is. Neither does it prevent our being justified in believing or even knowing that sense perception is reliable. This is so if there are no higher-level requirements for justification and knowledge, such as the requirement that we be justified in believing that sense perception is reliable. If we can have justified perceptual beliefs without already being justified in believing that sense perception is reliable, we can be justified in accepting the premises of the track-record argument and using it for attaining justification for the conclusion.

Alston does not suggest that there are higher-level requirements for knowledge and justification. His account of justification is a form of generic reliabilism that do not make such requirements. According to such reliabilism,

S’s belief that p is justified if and only if it has a sufficiently reliable causal source.

If reliabilism is true, we can very well be justified in believing the premises of the track-record argument without being justified in believing the conclusion. It merely requires that the conclusion be, in fact, true. If sense perception is reliable along with other relevant sources–such as introspection and inductive reasoning–we can be justified in accepting the premises and thus arrive at a justified belief in the conclusion by reasoning inductively from the premises. Moreover, nothing prevents our coming to know the conclusion by means of such reasoning.

What, then, is wrong with epistemically circular arguments? This is what Alston states:

Epistemic circularity does not in and of itself disqualify the argument. But even granting this point, the argument will not do its job unless we are justified in accepting its premises; and that is the case only if sense perception is in fact reliable. This is to offer a stone instead of bread. We can say the same of any belief-forming practice whatever, no matter how disreputable. We can just as well say of crystal ball gazing that if it is reliable, we can use a track-record argument to show that it is reliable. But when we ask whether one or another source of belief is reliable, we are interested in discriminating those that can be reasonably trusted from those that cannot. Hence merely showing that if a given source is reliable it can be shown by its record to be reliable, does nothing to indicate that the source belongs to the sheep rather that with the goats. (1993, 17)

This is puzzling. Earlier Alston grants that, assuming reliabilism, we can use an epistemically circular track-record argument to show that sense perception is reliable. Now he is suggesting that such an argument shows at most the conditional conclusion that if a given source is reliable it can be shown by its record to be reliable. This seems merely to contradict the point he already granted.

We can make sense of this if we distinguish between two kinds of showing. When Alston talks about showing he usually has in mind something we could call “epistemic showing.” Showing in this sense requires a good argument with justified premises. If we have such an epistemically circular argument for the reliability of sense perception, we can show the categorical conclusion that sense perception is reliable. Assuming that reliabilism is true and that sense perception, introspection and induction are reliable processes, the premises of the track-record argument are surely justified, and the justification of the premises is transmitted to the conclusion. If this is all that is required for showing, then epistemic circularity does not disqualify the argument.

There is another sense of showing, that of “dialectical showing.” Showing in this sense is relative to an audience, and it requires that we have an argument that our audience takes to be sound, otherwise we would be unable to rationally convince it. If we assume that our audience is skeptical about the reliability of sense perception, it is clear that we cannot convince such an audience with an epistemically circular argument. This is so because the audience would also be skeptical about the truth of the premises. Assuming that our audience is skeptical only about perception and not about introspection and induction, we can only show to such an audience Alston’s hypothetical conclusion: if sense perception is reliable, we can show–in the epistemic sense–that it is.

Whether this is what Alston has in mind or not, it is one possible diagnosis of the failure of epistemically circular arguments. Although they may provide justification for our reliability beliefs, they are unable to rationally remove doubts about reliability. They are not dialectically effective against the skeptic.

2. Epistemic Failure

The problem of epistemic circularity derives from our intuition that there is something wrong with it. Many philosophers have expressed doubts that this intuition is completely explained by dialectical considerations. The fault seems to be epistemic rather than just dialectical. Richard Fumerton (1995) and Jonathan Vogel (2000) argue that we cannot gain knowledge and justified beliefs by means of epistemically circular reasoning. They conclude that any account of knowledge or justification that allows this must be mistaken. Their target is reliabilism in particular. Fumerton writes:

You cannot use perception to justify the reliability of perception! You cannot use memory to justify the reliability of memory! You cannot use induction to justify the reliability of induction! Such attempts to respond to the skeptic’s concerns involve blatant, indeed pathetic, circularity. Frankly, this does seem right to me and I hope it seems right to you, but if it does, then I suggest you have a powerful reason to conclude that externalism is false. (1995, 177)

If the mere reliability of a process is sufficient for giving us justification, as reliabilism entails, then we can use it to obtain a justified belief even about its own reliability. According to Fumerton, this counterintuitive result shows that reliabilism is false.

Vogel (2000, 613-623) gives the example of Roxanne, who has a car with a highly reliable gas gauge and who believes implicitly what the gas gauge indicates, without knowing that it is reliable. In order to gain knowledge about the reliability of the gauge, she undertakes the following procedure. She looks at the gauge often and forms a belief not only about how much gas there is in the tank, but also about the reading of the gauge. For example, when the gauge reads ‘F’, she believes both that the gauge reads ‘F’ and that the tank is full. She combines these beliefs into the belief:

(1) On this occasion, the gauge reads ‘F’ and the tank is F.

Surely, the perceptual process by which Roxanne forms her belief about the reading of the gauge is reliable, but so is, by hypothesis, the process through which she reaches the belief that the tank is full. Roxanne’s belief in (1) is thus the result of a reliable process. She then repeats this process on several occasions and forms beliefs of the form:

(2) On this occasion, the gauge reads ‘X’ and the tank is X.

From a representative set of such beliefs, she concludes inductively that:

(3) The gauge is reliable.

Because induction is also a reliable process, the whole process by which Roxanne reaches her conclusion is reliable. Thus reliabilism allows that in this way she gains knowledge that the gauge is reliable.

Vogel assumes that this process, which he calls bootstrapping, is illegitimate and concludes that reliabilism goes wrong in improperly ratifying bootstrapping as a way of gaining knowledge.

We have an intuition that there is something wrong with this sort of epistemically circular reasoning. Here, it is difficult to explain the intuition in terms of some sort of dialectical failure because there is nobody who is questioning the reliability of the gauge and who needs to be convinced about the matter. It is merely assumed that Roxanne did not originally know that it was reliable. It follows from reliabilism that she can gain this knowledge by this sort of bootstrapping, which is contrary to our intuitions.

3. Easy Knowledge and the KR Principle

Epistemic circularity is not only a problem for reliabilism. As Alston pointed out, any epistemological theory that does not set higher-level requirements for knowledge or justified belief is bound to allow epistemic circularity. The problem is that such a theory makes knowledge and justified belief about reliability intuitively too easy.

Stewart Cohen (2002) argues that any theory that rejects the following principle allows knowledge about reliability too easily:

KR: A potential knowledge source K can yield knowledge for S, only if S knows K is reliable.

Theories that reject this KR principle allow that a belief source can deliver knowledge prior to one’s knowing that the source is reliable. Cohen calls such knowledge “basic” knowledge. (Note that he uses the phrase in a nonstandard way.) Theories that allow for basic knowledge can appeal to our basic knowledge in order to explain how we know that our belief sources are reliable:

According to such views, we first acquire a rich stock of basic knowledge about the world. Such knowledge, once obtained, enables us to learn how we are situated in the world, and so to learn, among other things, that our belief sources are reliable. (2002, 310)

In obtaining such knowledge of reliability we reason in a way that is epistemically circular. The problem is that we gain knowledge too easily.

It is not only reliabilism that rejects the KR principle: there are other currently popular theories that do so. For example, evidentialism makes knowledge a function of evidence. An evidentialist who denies the KR principle allows that one can know that p on the basis of evidence E without knowing that E is a reliable indication of the truth of p. Such evidentialism allows our gaining knowledge of reliability through epistemically circular reasoning.

However, the principle does not seem to be strong enough because even some theories that accept it do not avoid epistemic circularity, and thus make knowledge too easy. The KR principle, as Cohen formulates it, does not make any requirements about epistemic order. It does not require in particular that knowledge about the reliability of source K be prior to (or independent of) knowledge based on K. It allows that we gain both kinds of knowledge simultaneously.

4. Coherence and Reflective Knowledge

According to holistic coherentism, knowledge is generated simultaneously in the whole system of beliefs once a sufficient degree of coherence is achieved. It is clear that meta-level beliefs about the sources of belief and their reliability can increase the coherence of the whole system of beliefs. So coherentism that requires such a meta-level perspective into the reliability of the sources of belief satisfies the KR principle: I can know that p only if I also know that the source of my belief that p is reliable.

However, as James Van Cleve (2003, 55-57) points out, coherentism does not avoid the problem of easy knowledge. It allows that we gain knowledge through epistemically circular reasoning. The steps by which we gain such knowledge may be exactly the same as in the foundationalist version. The only difference is that when, according to foundationalism, knowledge is first generated in the premises and then transmitted to the conclusion, coherentism makes it appear simultaneously in the premises and in the conclusion. The fact that knowledge is not generated in the premises until the conclusion is reached does not make it less easy to attain knowledge.

Ernest Sosa (1997) suggests that we can resolve the problems of circularity by his distinction between animal knowledge and reflective knowledge, but as both Cohen (2002, 326) and Van Cleve (2003, 57) point out, Sosa’s account allows knowledge about reliability too easily. Animal knowledge is knowledge as it is understood in simple reliabilism: it requires just a true and reliably formed belief. So it does not satisfy the KR principle and allows easy knowledge. We can attain animal knowledge about the reliability of a source through epistemically circular reasoning.

Sosa’s point is that reflective knowledge satisfies the principle. In addition to animal knowledge, it requires a coherent system of beliefs that includes an epistemic perspective into the reliability of the sources of belief. So a source delivers reflective knowledge for me only if I know that the source is reliable, yet it is still true that the epistemically circular track-record argument provides all the ingredients needed for such reflective knowledge. I attain animal knowledge about the reliability of perception by reasoning from my animal knowledge about the truth of particular perceptual beliefs. Once I have attained this knowledge, my system of beliefs also achieves a sufficient degree of coherence that transfers my animal knowledge into reflective knowledge. All this happens still too easily. It happens in fact as easily as before. The only difference is the points at which different sorts of knowledge are attained. The reasoning itself is exactly the same.

It seems that we can avoid allowing easy knowledge only by strengthening the KR principle. It must require that knowledge of the reliability of source K be prior to knowledge based on K. We must know that the source is reliable independently of any knowledge based on the source. The problem with coherentism and Sosa’s account is that they reject this strengthened KR principle, and this is why they make knowledge too easy.

5. The Problem of the Criterion

By affirming the strengthened KR principle we avoid the easy-knowledge problem but are in danger of falling into skepticism. The strengthened principle leads to the ancient problem of the criterion.

Ancient Pyrrhonian skeptics were puzzled about the disagreements that prevailed about any object of inquiry. They insisted that, in order to resolve these disagreements and to attain any knowledge, we need criteria that distinguish beliefs that are true from those that are false. However, there are also disagreements about the right criteria of truth. In order to resolve these disagreements and to know what the right criteria are, we need to know already which beliefs are true–the ones the criteria are supposed to pick out. We are thus caught in a circle.

If we understand the right criteria of truth as reliable sources of belief–sources that mostly produce true beliefs–we arrive at the following formulation of the problem of the criterion:

(1) We can know that a belief based on source K is true only if we first know that K is reliable.

(2) We can know that K is reliable only if we first know that some beliefs based on source K are true.

Assumption (1) is a formulation of the strengthened KR principle. Together with assumption (2), it leads to skepticism: we cannot know which sources are reliable nor which beliefs are true. To be sure, (2) does not require us to know that beliefs based on K are true through K itself; we can rely on some other source. However, (1) posits that this other source can deliver knowledge only if we first know that it is reliable, and (2) that, in order to know this, we need to know that some beliefs based on it are true. In order to know this, in turn, we once again have to rely on some third source, and so on. Because we cannot have an infinite number of sources, sooner or later we have to rely on sources already relied on at some earlier point. We are thus reasoning in a circle, and circular reasoning is unable to provide knowledge.

The circle we are caught in is not epistemic. It is a straightforwardly logical circle. It is clear that a logical circle does not produce knowledge. Such a circle is nowhere connected to reality. Thus in trying to avoid epistemic circularity, we are caught in a more clearly vicious circle–a logical circle.

It is natural to think that epistemic circularity is the lesser evil. If we only have the alternatives of making knowledge too easy or impossible, most philosophers would surely choose the former. This may be the motivation behind currently popular reliabilist and evidentialist epistemologies that deny higher-level requirements for knowledge, but are these really our only options? Could we not reject assumption (2) instead of (1)?

6. Basic Reliability Knowledge

One might concede that a source can give us knowledge only if we first know that it is reliable, but still deny that this knowledge of reliability must in turn be inferred from some other knowledge. One might insist instead that our knowledge about our own reliability is basic or noninferential. This would break the skeptic’s circle.

Thomas Reid (1983, 275) seems to be the traditional advocate of this position. He takes it as a first principle that our cognitive faculties are reliable. He states that first principles are self-evident: we know them directly without deriving them from some other truths (257). How is it possible to know directly a generalization that is only contingently true? It may be easy to see how we can directly know a generalization, such as “All triangles have three angles,” which is a necessary truth: we can simply see its truth through a priori intuition. However, we cannot simply see that our faculties are reliable. The faculty of a priori reason does not give us knowledge of contingent generalizations.

Reid (259-260) posits that there is a special faculty for knowing the first principles, which he calls common sense. Thus, common sense tells us that our faculties are reliable. However, it cannot give us knowledge unless we first know that it is reliable. How can we know this? The only available answer seems to be that we also know this through common sense. (Bergmann 2004, 722-724) There is a serious problem if we assume the skeptic’s strengthened KR principle. This entails that we can know that common sense is reliable only if we first know that it is reliable. We must know it before we know it, which is impossible. We avoid this result if we go back to Cohen’s original KR principle (Van Cleve, 2003, 50-52), but then we face epistemic circularity once again.

According to the Reidian view, knowledge about the reliability of our faculties is basic, and the source of it is common sense. However, common sense delivers this knowledge only if it is itself known to be reliable. If we accept Cohen’s original KR principle and deny the skeptic’s requirement that this knowledge be prior to other knowledge delivered by common sense, we allow that common sense delivers simultaneously basic knowledge about the reliability of our faculties and about the reliability of common sense itself. This is a coherent position.

However, this Reidian view allows one kind of epistemic circularity. Although it is not quite the same kind as in the track-record argument, it allows that we can know that a faculty is reliable by using that very same faculty. The only difference is that this is basic knowledge and not knowledge based on reasoning. It seems that this view makes knowledge about reliability even easier than before.

If we wanted to determine whether to trust a guru, we could construct an inductive argument based on the premises about the truth of what he says and leading to the conclusion that he is reliable. If our belief in the premises is itself based on what he tells us, our argument is epistemically circular. It seems that this cannot be a way of gaining knowledge about his reliability in that it would be intuitively too easy. It would be even easier to base our belief in his reliability on his simply saying that he is reliable. If we cannot gain knowledge through epistemically circular reasoning, how could we gain it by taking this more direct route?

7. Wittgenstein, Entitlement and Practical Rationality

Let us grant that we somehow presuppose the reliability of our sources of belief when we form and evaluate beliefs. What kind of normative status do these presuppositions have if they cannot have the status of basic knowledge? Many philosophers have been inspired by Wittgenstein’s last notebooks published as On Certainty (1969, §§ 341-343):

K the questions that we raise and our doubts depend upon the fact that some propositions are exempt from doubt, are as it were like hinges on which they turn.

That is to say, it belongs to the logic of our scientific investigations that certain things are indeed not doubted.

But it isn’t that the situation is like this: We just can’t investigate everything, and for that reason we are forced to rest content with assumption. If I want the door to turn, the hinges must stay put.

The idea is that in every context of inquiry there are certain propositions that are not and cannot be doubted. They are the hinges that must stay put if we are to conduct inquiry at all. According to Wittgenstein, these hinge propositions cannot be justified, neither can we know them. They are the presuppositions that make justification and knowledge possible.

Wittgenstein (§§ 163, 337) suggests that such hinge propositions include propositions about the reliability of our sources of belief. This explains why we cannot gain knowledge about reliability through epistemically circular reasoning, because we cannot have such knowledge at all. Wittgenstein may have thought so because he took hinge “propositions¨ to have no factual content and thus to be neither true nor false. Thus our concepts of knowledge and justification would not apply to them. However, this view is not very intuitive. Surely the sentence “Sense perception is reliable” appears to express a genuine proposition that is either true or false. If it does express such a proposition, we can have doxastic attitudes to the proposition, and these attitudes can be evaluated epistemically.

Crispin Wright (2004) follows Wittgenstein but takes hinge propositions to be genuine propositions that are epistemically evaluable. He provides an account of the structure of justification that explains why the justification of the premises in certain valid arguments does not transmit to the conclusion. Although the epistemically circular track-record argument is an inductive argument, the same account explains the transmission failure here.

According to Wright’s account, we cannot be justified in accepting the premises of Alston’s track-record argument unless we are already justified in accepting the conclusion that sense perception is reliable. This is why the justification we may have for the premises does not transmit to the conclusion: it presupposes a prior justification for the conclusion. Thus Wright accepts a version of the skeptic’s strengthened KR principle, which effectively blocks epistemically circular reasoning.

He then tries to avoid skepticism by distinguishing between ordinary evidential justification and non-evidential justification he calls “entitlement.” In order to form justified perceptual beliefs, we must already be entitled to take it for granted that sense perception is reliable. However, because this entitlement is a kind of unearned justification that requires no evidential work, we can break the skeptic’s circle.

Wright’s entitlement is not based on sources of justification, such as perception, introspection, memory or reasoning. We get it by default, which is why the KR principle does not apply to it. Thus it avoids the problem of the Reidian account.

Unfortunately, it has its own problems. One of these concerns the nature of entitlement. According to Wright, it is a kind of rational entitlement, but what kind is it? This is how he comments on certain of Wittgenstein’s passages:

I take Wittgenstein’s point in these admittedly not unequivocal passages to be that this is essential: one cannot but take certain such things for granted. (2004, 189)

This line of reply concedes that the best sceptical arguments have something to teach us–that the limits of justification they bring out are genuine and essential–but then replies that, just for that reason, cognitive achievement must be reckoned to take place within such limits. The attempt to surpass them would result not in an increase in rigour or solidity but merely in cognitive paralysis. (2004, 191)

Wright argues here that we cannot but take certain things for granted. In order to engage in inquiry and to form justified beliefs, one must accept certain presuppositions. Refusing to do that would mean cognitive paralysis. As Duncan Pritchard (2005) comments, this seems to be a defense of the practical rationality of assuming that the sources of one’s beliefs are reliable. Nothing is said for the truth of those presuppositions or of the epistemic rationality of accepting them.

Alston defends more explicitly the practical rationality of taking our sources of belief to be reliable:

In the nature of the case, there is no appeal beyond the practices we find ourselves firmly committed to, psychologically and socially. We cannot look into any issue whatever without employing some way of forming and evaluating beliefs; that applies as much to issues concerning the reliability of doxastic practices as to any others. Hence there is no alternative to employing the practices we find to be firmly rooted in our lives, practices we could abandon or replace only with extreme difficulty if at all. (1993, 125)

Alston adds that the suspension of all belief is not an option, and that there is no reason to substitute our firmly established doxastic practices for some new ones because neither would there be any noncircular defense of these new practices. Alston makes it quite clear that this is a defense of the practical rationality of engaging in firmly established practices and taking them to be reliable.

However, this defense of the practical rationality of taking our sources of belief to be reliable does not contradict skepticism. In posing the problem of the criterion, the skeptic is not denying the practical rationality of our using the practices that we in fact use. What he or she is denying is the epistemic rationality or justification of the beliefs produced by them. That it would be practically rational for us to assume that the practices are reliable and that they therefore produce justified beliefs is not something the skeptic would deny.

Alston (2005, 240-242) has since rejected this practical validation argument for our sources of belief and settled for a simpler form of Wittgensteinian contextualism. Now he does not tell what kind of entitlement we have to the hinge propositions about the reliability of our sources. Perhaps there is no entitlement, and we just have to blindly trust in their reliability. How, then, does this differ from skepticism?

Curiously enough, neither Wright nor Alston really avoid the allowing of epistemic circularity. Alston even underlines the fact that epistemically circular arguments can produce justification for our beliefs about reliability. His point seems to be that whether this in fact happens is something that we can have only practical reasons for assuming, which does not really explain what is wrong with these arguments.

According to Wright, the justification of the premises does not transmit to the conclusion if it requires that we already be independently justified in accepting the conclusion. However, because this independent justification is a different sort of non-evidential justification–entitlement–it is unclear why the argument fails in transmitting evidential justification. Assuming that the entitlements are already in place–that we are entitled to take introspection, sense perception and inductive reasoning to be reliable–nothing prevents our also gaining evidential justification for the conclusion that sense perception is reliable. At least nothing in Wright’s account does so.

Thus the appeal to default entitlement or practical rationality does not solve our problem: it does not avoid epistemic circularity. At the same time, it may be too concessive to skepticism.

8. Sensitivity

It is possible to reject the KR principle without allowing epistemic circularity. One might simply deny–as Wittgenstein does–that we have any knowledge about our own reliability. One could defend this view–as Wittgenstein does not do–on the basis of the sensitivity condition of knowledge. Analyses of knowledge as defended by Fred Dretske (1971) and Robert Nozick (1981) set the following necessary condition for S‘s knowing that p:

Sensitivity: if it were not true that p, S would not believe that p.

According to Cohen (2002, 316), our beliefs about the reliability of our sources of belief do not satisfy this condition. Assume that we form a belief in the reliability of sense perception on the basis of epistemically circular reasoning. According to the sensitivity condition, we cannot know on this basis that sense perception is reliable if we believed on this basis that it is reliable even if it were not reliable. It seems that this is exactly what is wrong with such arguments: they would cause us to believe that a source is reliable even if it were not. A guru would tell us that he is reliable even if he were not.

The sensitivity condition concerns the possible worlds in which our belief is false but which are otherwise closest to the actual world. Alvin Goldman (1999, 86) suggests that the relevant alternative to the hypothesis that visual perception is reliable is that visual perception is randomly unreliable. If this is the case in the closest possible worlds in which our belief in the reliability of visual perception is false, it may be that we can, after all, know that visual perception is reliable, because in these worlds it would produce a massive amount of inconsistent beliefs, and therefore we would not believe that it is reliable. So, are the worlds in which visual perception is randomly unreliable the closest unreliability worlds? It may be rather that the closest worlds are those in which visual perception is systematically unreliable, and in these worlds we believe that it is reliable. If this is the case, the sensitivity accounts explain very well the intuition that we cannot gain knowledge through epistemically circular reasoning.

Sensitivity accounts of knowledge have not been popular in recent years because they deny the intuitively plausible principle that knowledge is closed under known logical implication. However, as Cohen (2002) has shown, this principle has counterintuitive consequences as does the denial of the KR principle. It allows cases in which we gain knowledge too easily, and perhaps we should therefore accept a sensitivity account that can handle both problems at once. However, a more serious problem is that there are cases of inductive knowledge that do not satisfy the sensitivity condition (Vogel, 1987).

9. Dialectical Ineffectiveness and the Inability to Defeat Defeaters

Arguments are dialectical creatures, so it is natural to evaluate them in terms of their dialectical effectiveness. We have seen already that epistemically circular arguments are poor in this respect. They are not able to rationally convince someone who doubts the conclusion because such a person also doubts the premises. Such arguments therefore fail to be dialectically effective. It could be suggested that this is enough to explain our intuition that there is something wrong with them, and that they need not involve any epistemic failure. (Markie 2005; Pryor 2004)

When it is a question of one’s own self-doubts, we could even allow a kind of epistemic failure. Let us assume that I have doubts about the reliability of my color vision: I believe that my color vision is not reliable, or I have considered the matter and have decided to suspend judgment about it. This doubt is a defeater for my color beliefs: it defeats or undermines my justification for them. Now it seems clear that I cannot defeat this defeater and regain my justification for these beliefs through epistemically circular reasoning. Such reasoning would rely on those very same beliefs for which I have lost the justification. It is unable to defeat reliability defeaters. (Bergmann 2004, 717-720)

We can thus readily explain the failure of epistemically circular arguments in cases in which there are serious doubts about reliability. They fail to remove these doubts. However, as the case of Roxanne shows, dialectical ineffectiveness and the failure to defeat defeaters cannot be the only things that are wrong with epistemic circularity. Neither Roxanne nor anybody else doubts her gas gauge; she is just ignorant about its reliability. She has no knowledge or justified beliefs about the matter. Our intuition is that she cannot gain knowledge or justified beliefs about the reliability of the gauge through the process of bootstrapping.

10. Epistemology and Dialectic

Although the term “epistemic circularity¨ is of recent origin, the phenomenon itself has been well known since the ancient skeptics. Ancient Pyrrhonian skeptics argued that we should suspend belief unless we can resolve the disagreements that there are about any object of inquiry. We could try to resolve these disagreements by relying on reliable sources of belief. Unfortunately, we cannot do this because there is also a disagreement about which sources are reliable, and this disagreement must be resolved first. However, we cannot resolve this disagreement because it would be dialectically ineffective to defend a set of such sources by appealing to premises that are themselves based on them. This is something that the skeptics most emphatically condemned. (Lammenranta 2008)

They also assumed that this sort of failure to resolve disagreements was not merely dialectical. It also prevented our having knowledge. If we should suspend belief about some question, we would certainly not know what the correct answer is. In connecting epistemology closely to dialectic, skeptics were just following the ancient tradition of Plato and Aristotle. This tradition continued in Descartes and early modern philosophy, and seems to be alive even today among the followers of John L. Austin, Ludwig Wittgenstein, and Wilfrid Sellars.

In spite of this influential tradition that connects epistemology closely with dialectic, the mainstream of contemporary analytic epistemology takes epistemology to be independent of dialectical issues. Accordingly, we may very well know even if we cannot rationally defend ourselves against those who disagree with us. After all, our sources of belief may, in fact, be reliable, and if this is the case they will provide us with reasons for believing that they are reliable and that those who disagree with us are wrong.

However, most of us have the intuition that it would be too easy to gain knowledge about our own reliability in this way. Perhaps the intuition shows that epistemology is more closely connected to dialectic than is currently acknowledged. This would explain our uneasiness with epistemic circularity and show that the ancient problem of the criterion is a genuine skeptical paradox for which we still lack a plausible solution.

11. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. “Epistemic Circularity.¨ Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 47 (1986). Reprinted in Epistemic Justification: Essays in the Theory of Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989: 319-349.
- The first and most influential account of the nature and significance of epistemic circularity.
Alston, William P. The Reliability of Sense Perception. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1993.
- Defends the inevitability of epistemic circularity and the practical rationality of engaging in firmly established doxastic practices.
Alston, William P. Beyond “Justification”: Dimensions of Epistemic Evaluation. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2005: ch. 11.
- Opts for Wittgensteinian contextualism concerning the status of reliability propositions.
Bergmann, Michael. “Epistemic Circularity: Malignant and Benign.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 69 (2004): 709-727.
- Explains when epistemically circular arguments do and when they do not provide knowledge about reliability, and defends the Reidian common-sense approach.
Cohen, Stewart. “Basic Knowledge and the Problem of the Problem of Easy Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 65 (2002): 309-329.
- Poses the problem of easy knowledge and tries to avoid epistemic circularity.
Dretske, Fred, “Conclusive Reasons.¨ Australasian Journal of Philosophy 49 ( 1971): 1-22. Reprinted in Perception, Knowledge and Belief. Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, 2000.
- Defends an early version of the sensitivity condition of knowledge.
Fumerton, Richard. Metaepistemology and Skepticism. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield, 1995: ch. 6.
- Accuses externalism of allowing epistemic circularity.
Goldman, Alvin I. Knowledge in a Social World, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999: section 3.3.
- A Bayesian defense of the epistemic value of epistemic circularity.
Lammenranta, Markus. “Reliabilism and Circularity.¨ Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56 (1996): 111-124.
- Relates epistemic circularity to Chisholm’s version of the problem of the criterion.
Lammenranta, Markus. “Reliabilism, Circularity, and the Pyrrhonian Problematic.¨ Journal of Philosophical Research 28 (2003): 311-328.
- Discusses reliabilist responses to epistemic circularity.
Lammenranta, Markus. “The Pyrrhonian Problematic.¨ The Oxford Handbook of Skepticism. Ed. John Greco. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008.
- Defends the dialectical nature and philosophical importance of the ancient Pyrrhonian problematic.
Lemos, Noah. “Epistemic Circularity Again.¨ Philosophical Issues 14 (2004): 254ƒ{270.
- Examines and rejects some objections to Sosa’s view that epistemic circularity does not prevent our knowing that our ways of forming beliefs are reliable.
Markie, Peter. “Easy Knowledge.¨ Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70 (2005): 406-416.
- Argues that the failure in epistemically circular argument is dialectical rather than epistemic.
Nozick, Robert. Philosophical Explanations. Harvard University Press: Cambridge, Mass., 1981: ch. 3.
- Defends the sensitivity (tracking) condition of knowledge and formulates the closure-based skeptical argument.
Pritchard, Duncan. “Wittgenstein’s On Certainty and Contemporary Anti-Scepticism.¨ Readings of Wittgenstein’s On Certainty. Eds. D. Moyal-Sharrock & W. H. Brenner. London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2005: 189V224.
- Discusses anti-skeptical views deriving from Wittgenstein’s On Certainty.
Pryor, James. “What’s Wrong with Moore’s Argument?¨ Philosophical Issues14 (2004): 349-378.
- Defends the epistemic respectability of Moore’s proof of the external world.
Reid, Thomas. Inquiry and Essays. Eds. Ronald E. Beanblossom & Keith Lehrer. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1983.
- An abbreviated edition of Reid’ major works on the philosophy of common sense.
Schmitt, Frederick F. “What Is Wrong with Epistemic Circularity?¨ Philosophical Issues 14 (2004): 379-402.
- Argues that epistemically circular arguments do have the power of answering doubts about reliability.
Sosa, Ernest. “Philosophical Scepticism and Epistemic Circularity.¨ Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 68 (1994): 263-290. Reprinted in Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Eds. Keith DeRose & Ted A. Warfield. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999: 93-114.
- Defends the inevitability and epistemic value of epistemically circular arguments.
Sosa, Ernest. “Reflective Knowledge in the Best Circles.¨ The Journal of Philosophy 94 (1997): 410-430.
- Uses the distinction between animal knowledge and reflective knowledge to explain why epistemic circles are not vicious.
Van Cleve, James. “Is Knowledge Easy–or Impossible? Externalism as the Only Alternative to Skepticism.¨ The Skeptics: Contemporary Essays. Ed. Steven Luper. Hampshire: Ashgate, 2003.
- Defends externalism and allowing epistemic circularity as the only alternatives to skepticism.
Vogel, Jonathan. “Tracking, Closure, and Inductive Knowledge.¨ The Possibility of Knowledge: Nozick and His Critics. Ed. Steven Luper-Foy. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield, 1987: 197-215.
- Criticizes the sensitivity condition of knowledge for not allowing inductive knowledge.
Vogel, Jonathan. “Reliabilism Leveled.¨ The Journal of Philosophy 97 (2000): 602-623.
- Criticizes reliabilism for allowing epistemically circular reasoning.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig. On Certainty. Eds. G. E. M. Anscombe & G. H. von Wright. Tr. D. Paul & G. E. M. Anscombe. Oxford: Blackwell, 1969.
- An influential defense of the view that the presuppositions of knowledge are not known.
Wright, Crispin. “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free).¨ Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 104 (2004): 167-211.
- Uses the concept of entitlement to resolve skeptical paradoxes.

Author Information

Markus Lammenranta
Email: markus.lammenranta@helsinki.fi
University of Helsinki
Finland

Inconsistent Mathematics

Inconsistent mathematics is the study of commonplace mathematical objects, like sets, numbers, and functions, where some contradictions are allowed. Tools from formal logic are used to make sure any contradictions are contained and that the overall theories remain coherent. Inconsistent mathematics began as a response to the set theoretic and semantic paradoxes such as Russell’s Paradox and the Liar Paradox—the response being that these are interesting facts to study rather than problems to solve—and has so far been of interest primarily to logicians and philosophers. More recently, though, the techniques of inconsistent mathematics have been extended into wider mathematical fields, such as vector spaces and topology, to study inconsistent structure for its own sake.

To be precise, a mathematical theory is a collection of sentences, the theorems, which are deduced through logical proofs. A contradiction is a sentence together with its negation, and a theory is inconsistent if it includes a contradiction. Inconsistent mathematics considers inconsistent theories. As a result, inconsistent mathematics requires careful attention to logic. In classical logic, a contradiction is always absurd: a contradiction implies everything. A theory containing every sentence is trivial. Classical logic therefore makes nonsense of inconsistency and is inappropriate for inconsistent mathematics. Classical logic predicts that the inconsistent has no structure. A paraconsistent logic guides proofs so that contradictions do not necessarily lead to triviality. With a paraconsistent logic, mathematical theories can be both inconsistent and interesting.

This article discusses inconsistent mathematics as an active research program, with some of its history, philosophy, results and open questions.

Introduction
1. An Example
Background
Geometry
Set Theory
Arithmetic
Analysis
Computer Science
References and Further Reading
1. Further Reading
2. References

1. Introduction

Inconsistent mathematics arose as an independent discipline in the twentieth century, as the result of advances in formal logic. In the nineteenth century, a great deal of extra emphasis was placed on formal rigor in proofs, because various confusions and contradictions had appeared in the analysis of real numbers. To remedy the situation required examining the inner workings of mathematical arguments in full detail. Mathematics had always been conducted through step-by-step proofs, but formal logic was intended to exert an extra degree of control over the proofs, to ensure that all and only the desired results would obtain. Various reconstructions of mathematical reasoning were advanced.

One proposal was classical logic, pioneered by Giuseppe Peano, Gottlob Frege, and Bertrand Russell. Another was paraconsistent logic, arising out of the ideas of Jan Łukasiewicz and N. A. Vasil’év around 1910, and ﬁrst realized in full by Jaśkowski in 1948. The ﬁrst to suggest paraconsistency as a ground for inconsistent mathematics was Newton da Costa in Brazil in 1958. Since then, his school has carried on a study of paraconsistent mathematics. Another school, centered in Australia and most associated with the name of Graham Priest, has been active since the 1970s. Priest and Richard Routley have forwarded the thesis that some inconsistent theories are not only interesting, but true; this is dialetheism.

Like any branch of mathematics, inconsistent mathematics is the study of abstract structures using proofs. Paraconsistent logic offers an unusually exacting proof guide that makes sure inconsistency does not get out of hand. Paraconsistency is not a magic wand or panacea. It is a methodology for hard work. Paraconsistency only helps us from getting lost, or falling into holes, when navigating through rough terrain.

a. An Example

Consider a collection of objects. The collection has some size, the number of objects in the collection. Now consider all the ways that these objects could be recombined. For instance, if we are considering the collection {a, b}, then we have four possible recombinations: just a, just b, both a and b, or neither a nor b. In general, if a collection has κ members, it has 2^κ recombinations. It is a theorem from the nineteenth century that, even if the collections in question are infinitely large, still κ < 2^κ, that is, the number of recombinations is always strictly larger than the number of objects in the original collection. This is Georg Cantor’s theorem.

Now consider the collection of all objects, the universe, V. This collection has some size,
|V|, and quite clearly, being by definition the collection of everything, this size is the absolutely largest size any collection can be. (Any collection is contained in the universe by definition, and so is no bigger than the universe.) By Cantor’s theorem, though, the number of recombinations of all the objects exceeds the original number of objects. So the size of the recombinations is both larger than, and cannot be larger than, the universe,

This is Cantor’s paradox. Inconsistent mathematics is unique in that, if rigorously argued, Cantor’s paradox is a theorem.

2. Background

a. Motivations

There are at least two reasons to take an interest in inconsistent mathematics, which roughly fall under the headings of pure and applied. The pure reason is to study structure for its own sake. Whether or not it has anything to do with physics, for example, Reimann geometry is beautiful. If the ideas displayed in inconsistent mathematics are rich and elegant and support unexpected developments that make deep connections, then people will study it. G. H. Hardy’s A Mathematician’s Apology (1940) makes a stirring case that pure mathematics is inherently worth doing, and inconsistent mathematics provides some panoramic views not available anywhere else.

The applied reasons derive from a longstanding project at the foundations of mathematics. Around 1900, David Hilbert proposed a program to ensure mathematical security. Hilbert wanted:

to formalize all mathematical reasoning into an exact notation with algorithmic rules;
to provide axioms for all mathematical theories, such that no contradictions are provable (consistency), and all true facts are provable (completeness).

Hilbert’s program was (in part) a response to a series of conceptual crises and responses from ancient Greece through Issac Newton and G. W. Leibniz (see section 6 below) to Cantor. Each crisis arose due to the imposition of some objects that did not behave well in the theories of the day—most dramatically in Russell’s paradox, which seems to be about logic itself.

The inconsistency would not have been such trouble, except the logic employed at that time was explosive: From a contradiction, anything at all can be proved, so Russell’s paradox was a disaster. In 1931, Kurt Gödel’s theorems showed that consistency is incompatible with completeness, that any complete foundation for mathematics will be inconsistent. Hilbert’s program as stated is dead, and with it even more ambitious projects like Frege-Russell logicism.

The failure of completeness was hard to understand. Hilbert and many others had felt that any mathematical question should be amenable to a mathematical answer. The motive to inconsistency, then, is that an inconsistent theory can be complete. In light of Gödel’s result, an inconsistent foundation for mathematics is the only remaining candidate for completeness.

b. Perspectives

There are different ways to view the place of inconsistent mathematics, ranging from the ideological to the pragmatic.

The most extreme view is that inconsistent mathematics is a rival to, or replacement for, classical consistent mathematics. This seems to have been Routley’s intent. Routley wanted to perfect an “ultramodal universal logic,” which would be a flexible and powerful reasoning tool applicable to all subjects and in all situations. Routley argued that some subjects and situations are intractably inconsistent, and so the universal logic would be paraconsistent. He wanted such a logic to underly not only set theory and arithmetic, but metaphysics, ecology and economics. (For example, Routley and Meyer [1976] suggest that our economic woes are caused by using classical logic in economic theory.) Rotuley (1980, p.927) writes:

There are whole mathematical cities that have been closed off and partially abandoned because of the outbreak of isolated contradictions. They have become like modern restorations of ancient cities, mostly just patched up ruins visited by tourists.

In order to sustain the ultramodal challenge to classical logic it will have to be shown that even though leading features of classical logic and theories have been rejected, … by going ultramodal one does not lose great chunks of the modern mathematical megalopolis. … The strong ultramodal claim—not so far vindicated—is the expectedly brash one: we can do everything you can do, only better, and we can do more.

A more restrained, but still unorthodox, view is of inconsistency as a non-revisionary extension of classical theory. There is nothing wrong with the classical picture of mathematics, says a proponent of this position, except if we think that the classical picture exhausts all there is to know. A useful analogy is the extension of the rational numbers by the irrational numbers, to get the real numbers. Rational numbers are not wrong; they are just not all the numbers. This moderate line is found in Priest’s work. As articulated by da Costa (1974, p.498):

It would be as interesting to study the inconsistent systems as, for instance, the non-euclidean geometries: we would obtain a better idea of the nature of certain paradoxes, could have a better insight on the connections amongst the various logical principles necessary to obtain determinate results, etc.

In a similar vein, Chris Mortensen argues that many important questions about mathematics are deeper than consistency or completeness.

A third view is even more open-minded. This is to see all theories (within some basic constraints) as genuine, interesting and useful for different purposes. Jc Beall and Greg Restall have articulated a version of this view at length, which they call logical pluralism.

c. Methods

There are at least two ways to go about mathematical research in this ﬁeld. The first is axiomatic. The second is model theoretic. The axiomatic approach is very pure. We pick some axioms and inference rules, some starting assumptions and a logic, and try to prove some theorems, with the aim of producing something on the model of Euclid, or Russell and A. N. Whitehead’s Principia Mathematica. This would be a way of obtaining results in inconsistent mathematics independently, as if we were discovering mathematics for the first time. On the axiomatic approach there is no requirement that the same theorems as classical mathematics be proved. The hardest work goes into choosing a logic that is weak enough to be paraconsistent, but strong enough to get results, and formulating the definitions and starting assumptions in a way that is compatible with the logic. Little work has so far been done using axiomatics.

By far more attention has been given to the model theoretic approach, because it allows inconsistent theories to “ride on the backs” of already developed consistent theories. The idea here is to build up models—domains of discourse, along with some relations between the objects in the domain, and an interpretation—and to read off facts about the attached theory. A way to do this is to take a model from classical mathematics, and to tinker with the interpretation, as in collapsed models of arithmetic (section 5 below). The model theoretic approach shows how different logics interact with different mathematical structures. Mortensen has followed through on this in a wide array of subjects, from the differential calculus to vector spaces to topology to category theory, always asking: Under what conditions is identity well-behaved? Let Φ(a) be some sentence about an object a. Mortensen’s question is, if a = b holds in a theory, then is it the case that Φ(a) exactly when Φ(b)? It turns out that the answer to this question is extremely sensitive to small changes in logic and interpretations, and the answer can often be “no.”

Most of the results obtained to date have been through the model theoretic approach, which has the advantage of maintaining a connection with classical mathematics. The model theory approach has the same disadvantage, since it is unlikely that radically new or robustly inconsistent ideas will arise from always beginning at classical ideas.

d. Proofs

It is often thought that inconsistent mathematics faces a grave problem. A very common mathematical proof technique is reductio ad absurdum. The concern, then, is that if contradictions are not absurd—a fortiori, if a theory has contradictions in it—then reductio is not possible. How can mathematics be done without the most common sort of indirect proof?

The key to working inconsistent mathematics is its logic. Much hinges on which paraconsistent logic we are using. For instance, in da Costa’s systems, if a proposition is marked as “consistent,” then reductio is allowed. Similarly, in most relevance logics, contraposition holds. And so forth. The reader is recommended to the bibliography for information on paraconsistent logic. Independently of logic, the following may help.

In classical logic, all contradictions are absurd; in a paraconsistent logic this is not so. But some things are absurd nevertheless. Classically, contradiction and absurdity play the same role, of being a rejection device, a reason to rule out some possibility. In inconsistent mathematics, there are still rejection devices. Anything that leads to a trivial theory is to be rejected. More, suppose we are doing arithmetic and hypothesize that Φ. But we ﬁnd that Φ has as a consequence that j=k for every number j, k. Now, we are looking for interesting inconsistent structure. This may not be full triviality, but 0 = 1 is nonsense. Reject Φ.

There are many consistent structures that mathematicians do not, and will never, investigate, not by force of pure logic but because they are not interesting. Inconsistent mathematicians, irrespective of formal proof procedures, do the same.

3. Geometry

Intuitively, M. C. Escher’s “Ascending, Descending” is a picture of an impossible structure—a staircase that, if you walked continuously along it, you would be going both up and down at the same time. Such a staircase may be called impossible. The structure as a whole seems to present us with an inconsistent situation; formally, deﬁning down as not up, then a person walking the staircase would be going up and not up, at the same time, in the same way, a contradiction. Nevertheless, the picture is coherent and interesting. What sorts of mathematical properties does it have? The answers to this and more would be the start of an inconsistent geometry.

So far, the study has focused on the impossible pictures themselves. A systematic study of these pictures is being carried out by the Adelaide school. Two main results have been obtained. First, Bruno Ernst conjectured that one cannot rotate an impossible picture. This was refuted in 1999 by Mortensen; later, Quigley designed computer simulations of rotating impossible Necker cubes. Second, all impossible pictures have been given a preliminary classiﬁcation of four basic forms: Necker cubes, Reutersvärd triangles, Schuster pipes or fork, and Ernst stairs. It is thought that these forms exhaust the universe of impossible pictures. If so, an important step towards a fuller geometry will have been taken, since, for example, a central theme in surface geometry is to classify surfaces as either convex, flat, or concave.

Most recently, Mortensen and Leishman (2009) have characterized Necker cubes, including chains of Neckers, using linear algebra. Otherwise, algebraic and analytic methods have not yet been applied in the same way they have been in classical geometry. Inconsistent equational expressions are not at the point where a robust answer can be given to questions of length, area, volume etc. On the other hand, as the Adelaide school is showing, the ancient Greeks do not have a monopoly on basic “circles drawn in sand” geometric discoveries.

4. Set Theory

Set theory is one of the most investigated areas in inconsistent mathematics, perhaps because there is the most consensus that the theories under study might be true. It is here we have perhaps the most important theorem for inconsistent mathematics, Ross Brady’s (2006) proof that inconsistent set theory is non-trivial.

Set theory begins with two basic assumptions, about the existence and uniqueness of sets:

A set is any collection of objects all sharing some property Φ;
Sets with exactly the same members are identical.

These are the principles of comprehension (a.k.a. abstraction) and extensionality, respectively. In symbols,

x ∈ {z : Φ(z)} ↔ Φ(x);
x = y ↔ ∀z (z ∈ x ↔ z ∈ y).

Again, these assumptions seem true. When the first assumption, the principle of comprehension, was proved to have inconsistent consequences, this was felt to be highly paradoxical. The inconsistent mathematician asserts that a theory implying an inconsistency is not automatically equivalent to a theory being wrong.

Newton da Costa was the ﬁrst to develop an openly inconsistent set theory in the 1960s, based on Alonzo Church’s set theory with a universal set, or what is similar, W. V. O. Quine’s new foundations. In this system, axioms like those of standard set theory are assumed, along with the existence of a Russell set

R = {x : x ∉ x}

and a universal set

V = {x : x = x}.

Da Costa has deﬁned “russell relations” and extended this foundation to model theory, arithmetic and analysis.

Note that V ∈ V, since V = V. This shows that some sets are self-membered. This also means that V ≠ R, by the axiom of extensionality. On the other hand, in perhaps the first truly combinatorial theorem of inconsistent mathematics, Arruda and Batens (1982) proved

where ∪R is the union of R, the set of all the members of members of R. This says that every set is a member of a non-self-membered set. The Arruda-Batens result was obtained with a very weak logic, and shows that there are real set theoretical theorems to be learned about inconsistent objects. Arruda further showed that

where P (X) denotes all the subsets of X and ⊆ is the subset relation.

Routley, meanwhile, in 1977 took up his own dialetheic logic and used it on a full comprehension principle. Routley went as far as to allow a comprehension principle where the set being defined could appear in its own definition. A more mundane example of a set appearing in its own defining condition could be the set of “critics who only criticize each other.” One of Routley’s examples is the ultimate inconsistent set,

x ∈ Z ↔ x ∉ Z.

Routley indicated that the usual axioms of classical set theory can be proven as theorems—including a version of the axiom of choice—and began work towards a full reconstruction of Cantorian set theory.

The crucial step in the development of Routley’s set theory came in 1989 when Brady adapted an idea from 1971 to produce a model of dialetheic set theory, showing that it is not trivial. Brady proves that there is a model in which all the axioms and consequences of set theory are true, including some contradictions like Russell’s, but in which some sentences are not true. By the soundness of the semantics, then, some sentences are not provable, and the theory is decidedly paraconsistent. Since then Brady has considerably reﬁned and expanded his result.

A stream of papers considering models for paraconsistent set theory has been coming out of Europe as well. Olivier Esser has determined under what conditions the axiom of choice is true, for example. See Hinnion and Libert (2008) for an opening into this work.

Classical set theory, it is well known, cannot answer some fundamental questions about inﬁnity, Cantor’s continuum hypothesis being the most famous. The theory is incomplete, just as Gödel predicted it would be. Inconsistent set theory, on the other hand, appears to be able to answer some of these questions. For instance, consider a large cardinal hypothesis, that there are cardinals λ such that for any κ < λ, also 2^κ < λ. The existence of large cardinals is undecidable by classical set theory. But recall the universe, as we did in the introduction (section 1), and its size |V|. Almost obviously, |V| is such large a cardinal, just because everything is smaller than it. Taking the full sweep of sets into account, the hypothesis is true.

Set theory is the lingua franca of mathematics and the home of mathematical study of infinity. Since Zeno’s paradoxes it has been obvious that there is something paradoxical about infinity. Since Russell’s paradox, it has been obvious that there is something paradoxical about set theory. So a rigorously developed paraconsistent set theory serves two purposes. First, it provides a reliable (inconsistent) foundation for mathematics, at least in the sense of providing the basic toolkit for expressing mathematical ideas. Second, the mathematics of infinity can be refined to cover the inconsistent cases like Cantor’s paradox, and cases that have yet to be considered. See the references for what has been done in inconsistent set theory so far; what can be still be done in remains one of the discipline’s most exciting open questions.

5. Arithmetic

An inconsistent arithmetic may be considered an alternative or variant on the standard theory, like a non-euclidean geometry. Like set theory, though, there are some who think that an inconsistent arithmetic may be true, for the following reason.

Gödel, in 1931, found a true sentence G about numbers such that, if G can be decided by arithmetic, then arithmetic is inconsistent. This means that any consistent theory of numbers will always be an incomplete fragment of the whole truth about numbers. Gödel’s second incompleteness theorem states that, if arithmetic is consistent, then that very fact is unprovable in arithmetic. Gödel’s incompleteness theorems state that all consistent theories are terminally unable to process everything that we know is true about the numbers. Priest has argued in a series of papers that this means that the whole truth about numbers is inconsistent.

The standard axioms of arithmetic are Peano’s, and their consequences—the standard theory of arithmetic—is called P A. The standard model of arithmetic is N = {0, 1, 2, …}, zero and its successors. N is a model of arithmetic because it makes all the right sentences true. In 1934 Skolem noticed that there are other (consistent) models that make all the same sentences true, but have a different shape—namely, the non-standard models include blocks of objects after all the standard members of N. The consistent non-standard models are all extensions of the standard model, models containing extra objects. Inconsistent models of arithmetic are the natural dual, where the standard model is itself an extension of a more basic structure, which also makes all the right sentences true.

Part of this idea goes back to C. F. Gauss, who ﬁrst introduced the idea of a modular arithmetic, like that we use to tell the time on analog clocks: On a clock face, 11 + 2 = 1, since the hands of the clock revolve around 12. In this case we say that 11 + 2 is congruent to 1 modulo 12. An important discovery in the late 19th century was that arithmetic facts are reducible to facts about a successor relation starting from a base element. In modular arithmetic, a successor function is wrapped around itself. Gauss no doubt saw this as a useful technical device. Inconsistent number theorists have considered taking such congruences much more seriously.

Inconsistent arithmetic was ﬁrst investigated by Robert Meyer in the 1970’s. There he took the paraconsistent logic R and added to it axioms governing successor, addition, multiplication, and induction, giving the system R#. In 1975 Meyer proved that his arithemtic is non-trivial, because R# has models. Most notably, R# has ﬁnite models with a two element domain {0, 1}, with the successor function moving in a very tight circle over the elements. Such models make all the theorems of R# true, but keep equations like 0 = 1 just false.

The importance of such ﬁnite models is just this: The models can be represented within the theory itself, showing that a paraconsistent arithmetic can prove its own non-triviality. In the case of Meyer’s arithemetic, R# has a ﬁnitary consistency proof, formalizable in R#. Thus, in non-classical contexts, Gödel’s second incompleteness theorem loses its bite. Since 1976 relevance logicians have studied the relationship between R# and PA. Their hope was that R# contains PA as a subtheory and could replace PA as a stronger, more genuine arithmetic. The outcome of that project for our purposes is the development of inconsistent models of arithmetic. Following Dunn, Meyer, Mortensen, and Friedman, these models have now been extensively studied by Priest, who bases his work not on the relevant logic R but on the more ﬂexible logic LP.

Priest has found inconsistent arithmetic to have an elegant general structure. Rather than describe the details, here is an intuitive example. We imagine the standard model of arithmetic, up to an inconsistent element

n = n + 1.

This n is suspected to be a very, very large number, “without physical reality or psychological meaning.” Depending on your tastes, it is the greatest ﬁnite number or the least inconsistent number. We further imagine that for j, k > n, we have j=k. If in the classical model j≠ k, then this is true too; hence we have an inconsistency, j=k and j≠ k. Any fact true of numbers greater than n are true of n, too, because after n, all numbers are identical to n. No facts from the consistent model are lost. This technique gives a collapsed model of arithmetic.

Let T be all the sentences in the language of arithmetic that are true of N; then let T(n) similarly be all the sentences true of the numbers up to n, an inconsistent number theory. Since T(n) does not contradict T about any numbers below n, if n > 0 then T(n) is non-trivial. (It does not prove 0 = 1, for instance.) The sentences of T(n) are representable in T(n), and its language contains a truth predicate for T(n). The theory can prove itself sound. The Gödel sentence for T(n) is provable in T(n), as is its negation, so the theory is inconsistent. Yet as Meyer proved, the non-triviality of T(n) can be established in T(n) by a finite procedure.

Most striking with respect to Hilbert’s program, there is a way, in principle, to figure out for any arithmetic sentence Φ whether or not Φ holds, just by checking all the numbers up to n. This means that T(n) is decidable, and that there must be axioms guaranteed to deliver every truth about the collapsed model. This means that an inconsistent arithmetic is coherent and complete.

6. Analysis

Newton and Leibniz independently developed the calculus in the 17th century. They presented ingenious solutions to outstanding problems (rates of change, areas under curves) using infinitesimally small quantities. Consider a curve and a tangent to the curve. Where the tangent line and the curve intersect can be though of as a point. If the curve is the trajectory of some object in motion, this point is an instant of change. But a bit of thought shows that it must be a little more than a point—otherwise, as a measure a rate of change, there would be no change at all, any more than a photograph is in motion. There must be some smudge. On the other hand, the instant must be less than any finite quantity, because there are inﬁnitely many such instants. An infinitesimal would respect both these concerns, and with these provided, a circle could be construed as infinitely many infinitesimal tangent segments.

Infinitesimals were essential, not only for building up the conceptual steps to inventing calculus, but in getting the right answers. Yet it was pointed out, most famously by Bishop George Berkeley, that infinitesimals were poorly understood and were being used inconsistently in equations. Calculus in its original form was outright inconsistent. Here is an example. Suppose we are differentiating the polynomial f(x) =ax²+bx+c. Using the original definition of a derivative,

In the example, ε is an infinitesimal. It marks a small but non-trivial neighborhood around x, and can be divided by, so it is not zero. Nevertheless, by the end ε has simply disappeared. This example suggests that paraconsistent logic is more than a useful technical device. The example shows that Leibniz was reasoning with contradictory information, and yet did not infer everything. On the contrary, he got the right answer. Nor is this an isolated incident. Mathematicians seem able to sort through “noise” and derive interesting truths, even out of contradictory data sets. To capture this, Brown and Priest (2004) have developed a method they call “chunk and permeate” to model reasoning in the early calculus. The idea is to take all the information, including say ε = 0 and ε ≠ 0, and break it into smaller chunks. Each chunk is consistent, without conflicting information, and one can reason using classical logic inside of a chunk. Then a permeation relation is defined which controls the information flow between chunks. As long as the permeation relation is carefully defined, conclusions reached in one chunk can ﬂow to another chunk and enter into reasoning chains there. Brown and Priest propose this as a model, or rational reconstruction, of what Newton and Leibniz were doing.

Another, more direct tack for inconsistent mathematics is to work with infinitesimal numbers themselves. There are classical theories of infinitesimals due to Abraham Robinson (the hyperreals), and J. H. Conway (the surreals). Mortensen has worked with differential equations using hyperreals. Another approach is from category theory. Tiny line segments (“linelets”) of length ϵ are considered, such that ϵ² = 0 but it is not the case that ϵ = 0. In this theory, it is also not the case that ϵ ≠ 0, so the logical law of excluded middle fails. The category theory approach is the most like inconsistent mathematics, then, since it involves a change in the logic. However, the most obvious way to use linelets with paraconsistent logics, to say that both ϵ = 0 and ϵ ≠ 0 are true, means we are dividing by 0 and so is probably too coarse to work.

In general the concept of continuity is rich for inconsistent developments. Moments of change, the ﬂow of time, and the very boundaries that separate objects have all been considered from the standpoint of inconsistent mathematics.

7. Computer Science

The questions posed by David Hilbert can be stated in very modern language:

Is there a computer program to decide, for any arithmetic statement, whether or not the statement can be proven? Is there a program to decide, for any arithmetic statement, whether or not the statement is true? We have already seen that Gödel’s theorems devastated Hilbert’s program, answering these questions in the negative. However, we also saw that inconsistent arithmetic overcomes Gödel’s results and can give a positive answer to these questions. It is natural to extend these ideas into computer science.

Hilbert’s program demands certain algorithms—a step-by-step procedure that can be carried out without insight or creativity. A Turing machine runs programs, some of which halt after a ﬁnite number of steps, and some of which keep running forever. Is there a program E that can tell us in advance whether a given program will halt or not? If there is, then consider the program E*, which exists if E does by deﬁning it as follows. When considering some program x, E* halts if and only if x keeps running when given input x. Then

E* halts for E*
if and only if
E* does not halt for E*,

which implies a contradiction. Turing concluded that there is no E*, and so there is no E—that there cannot be a general decision procedure.

Any program that can decide in advance the behavior of all other programs will be inconsistent.

A paraconsistent system can occasionally produce contradictions as an output, while its procedure remains completely deterministic. (It is not that the machine occasionally does and does not produce an output.) There is, in principle, no reason a decision program cannot exist. Richard Sylvan identifies as a central idea of paraconsistent computability theory the development of machines “to compute diagonal functions that are classically regarded as uncomputable.” He discusses a number of rich possibilities for a non-classical approach to algorithms, including a fixed-point result on the set of all algorithmic functions, and a prototype for dialetheic machines.

Important results have been obtained by the paraconsistent school in Brazil—da Costa and Doria in 1994, and Agudelo and Carnielli in 2006. Like quantum computation, though, at present the theory of paraconsistent machines outstrips the hardware. Machines that can compute more than Turing machines await advances in physics.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Further Reading

Priest’s In Contradiction (2006) is the best place to start. The second edition contains material on set theory, continuity, and inconsistent arithmetic (summarizing material previously published in papers). A critique of inconsistent arithmetic is in Shapiro (2002). Franz Berto’s book, How to Sell a Contradiction (2007), is harder to find, but also an excellent and perhaps more gentle introduction.

Some of da Costa’s paraconsistent mathematics is summarized in the interesting collection Frontiers of Paraconsistency (2000)—the proceedings of a world congress on paraconsistency edited by Batens et al. More details are in Jacquette’s Philosophy of Logic (2007) handbook; Beall’s paper in that volume covers issues about truth and inconsistency.

Those wanting more advanced mathematical topics should consult Mortensen’s Inconsistent Mathematics (1995). For impossible geometry, his recent pair of papers with Leishman are a promising advance. His school’s website is well worth a visit. Brady’s Universal Logic (2006) is the most worked-out paraconsistent set theory to date, but not for the faint of heart.

If you can find it, read Routley’s seminal paper, “Ultralogic as Universal?”, reprinted as an appendix to his magnum opus, Exploring Meinong’s Jungle (1980). Before too much confusion arises, note that Richard Routley and Richard Sylvan, whose posthumous work is collected by Hyde and Priest in Sociative Logics and their Applications (2000), in a selfless feat of inconsistency, are the same person.

For the how-to of paraconsistent logics, consult both the entry on relevance and paraconsistency in Gabbay & Günthner’s Handbook of Philosophical Logic volume 6 (2002), or Priest’s textbook An Introduction to Non-Classical Logic (2008). For paraconsistent logic and its philosophy more generally see Routley, Priest and Norman’s 1989 edited collection. The collection The Law of Non-Contradiction (Priest et al. 2004) discusses the philosophy of paraconsistency, as does Priest’s Doubt Truth be a Liar (2006).

For the broader philosophical issues associated with inconsistent mathematics, especially in applications (for example, consequences for realism and antirealism debates), see Mortensen (2009a) and Colyvan (2009).

b. References

Arruda, A. I. & Batens, D. (1982). “Russell’s set versus the universal set in paraconsistent set theory.” Logique et Analyse, 25, pp. 121-133.
Batens, D., Mortensen, C. , Priest, G., & van Bendegem, J-P., eds. (2000). Frontiers of Paraconsistent Logic. Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Berto, Francesco (2007). How to Sell a Contradiction. Studies in Logic v. 6. College Publications.
Brady, Ross (2006). Universal Logic. CSLI Publications.
Brown, Bryson & Priest, G. (2004). “Chunk and permeate i: the inﬁnitesimal calculus.” Journal of Philosophical Logic, 33, pp. 379–88.
Colyvan, Mark (2008). “The ontological commitments of inconsistent theories.” Philosophical Studies, 141(1):115 – 23, October.
Colyvan, Mark (2009). “Applying Inconsistent Mathematics,” in O. Bueno and Ø. Linnebo (eds.), New Waves in Philosophy of Mathematics, Palgrave MacMillan, pp. 160-72
da Costa, Newton C. A. (1974). “On the theory of inconsistent formal systems.” Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic, 15, pp. 497– 510.
da Costa, Newton C. A. (2000). Paraconsistent mathematics. In Batens et al. 2000, pp. 165–180.
da Costa, Newton C.A., Krause, D´ecio & Bueno, Ot´avio (2007). “Paraconsistent logics and paraconsistency.” In Jacquette 2007, pp. 791 – 912.
Gabbay, Dov M. & Günthner, F. eds. (2002). Handbook of Philosophical Logic, 2nd Edition, volume 6, Kluwer.
Hinnion,Roland & Libert, Thierry (2008). “Topological models for extensional partial set theory.” Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic, 49(1).
Hyde, Dominic & Priest, G., eds. (2000). Sociative Logics and their Applications: Essays by the Late Richard Sylvan. Ashgate.
Jacquette, Dale, ed. (2007). Philosophy of Logic. Elsevier: North Holland.
Libert, Thierry (2004). “Models for paraconsistent set theory.” Journal of Applied Logic, 3.
Mortensen, Chris (1995). Inconsistent Mathematics. Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Mortensen, Chris (2009a). “Inconsistent mathematics: Some philosophical implications.” In A.D. Irvine, ed., Handbook of the Philosophy of Science Volume 9: Philosophy of Mathematics. North Holland/Elsevier.
Mortensen, Chris (2009b). “Linear algebra representation of necker cubes II: The routley functor and necker chains.” Australasian Journal of Logic, 7.
Mortensen, Chris & Leishman, Steve (2009). “Linear algebra representation of necker cubes I: The crazy crate.” Australasian Journal of Logic, 7.
Priest, Graham, Beall, J.C. & Armour-Garb, B., eds. (2004). The Law of Non-Contradiction. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Priest, Graham (1994). “Is arithmetic consistent?” Mind, 103.
Priest, Graham (2000). “Inconsistent models of arithmetic, II: The general case.” Journal of Symbolic Logic, 65, pp. 1519–29.
Priest, Graham (2002). “Paraconsistent logic.” In Gabbay and Günthner, eds. 2002, pp. 287–394.
Priest, Graham (2006a). Doubt Truth Be A Liar. Oxford University Press.
Priest, Graham (2006b). In Contradiction: A Study of the Transconsistent. Oxford University Press. second edition.
Priest, Graham (2008). An Introduction to Non-Classical Logic. Cambridge University Press, second edition.
Priest, Graham, Routley, R. & Norman, J. eds. (1989). Paraconsistent Logic: Essays on the Inconsistent. Philosophia Verlag.
Routley, Richard (1977). “Ultralogic as universal?” Relevance Logic Newsletter, 2, pp. 51–89. Reprinted in Routley 1980.
Routley, Richard (1980). “Exploring Meinong’s Jungle and Beyond.” Philosophy Department, RSSS, Australian National University, 1980. Interim Edition, Departmental Monograph number 3.
Routley, Richard & Meyer, R. K. (1976). “Dialectical logic, classical logic and the consistency of the world.” Studies in Soviet Thought, 16, pp. 1–25.
Shapiro, Stewart (2002). “Incompleteness and inconsistency.” Mind, 111, pp. 817 – 832.

Author Information

Zach Weber
Email: zweber@unimelb.edu.au
University of Sydney, University of Melbourne
Australia

Philosophy of Language

Those who use the term “philosophy of language” typically use it to refer to work within the field of Anglo-American analytical philosophy and its roots in German and Austrian philosophy of the early twentieth century. Many philosophers outside this tradition have views on the nature and use of language, and the border between “analytical” and “continental” philosophy is becoming more porous with time, but most who speak of this field are appealing to a specific set of traditions, canonical authors and methods. The article takes this more narrow focus in order to describe a tradition’s history, but readers should bear in mind this restriction of scope.

The history of the philosophy of language in the analytical tradition begins with advances in logic and with tensions within traditional accounts of the mind and its contents at the end of the nineteenth century. A revolution of sorts resulted from these developments, often known as the “Linguistic Turn” in philosophy. However, its early programs ran into serious difficulties by mid-twentieth century, and significant changes in direction came about as a result. Section 1 below addresses the precursors and early stages of the “Linguistic Turn,” while Section 2 addresses its development by the Logical Positivists and others. Section 3 outlines the sudden shifts that resulted from the works of Quine and Wittgenstein, and Section 4 charts the major approaches and figures that have followed from mid-century to the present.

Frege, Russell and the Linguistic Turn
Early Analytical Philosophy of Language
Mid-century Revolutions
1. Quine and the Analytic/Synthetic Distinction
2. The Later Wittgenstein
Major Areas in the Contemporary Field
Future Directions and Emerging Debates
References and Further Reading

1. Frege, Russell and the Linguistic Turn

a. Referential Theories of Meaning

Much of the stage-setting for the so-called “Linguistic Turn” in Anglo-American philosophy took place in the mid nineteenth century. Attention turned to language as many came to see it as a focal point in understanding belief and representation of the world. Language came to be seen as the “medium of conceptualization,” as Wilfrid Sellars would later put it. Idealists working in Kant’s wake had developed more sophisticated “transcendental” accounts of the conditions for the possibility of experience, and this evoked strong reactions from more realist philosophers and those sympathetic to the natural sciences. Scientists also made advances in the 1860s and 70s in describing cognitive functions, like speech production and comprehension, as natural phenomena, including their discovery of Broca’s area and Wernicke’s area, which are two neural centers of linguistic activity.

John Stuart Mill‘s work around this time reinvigorated British empiricism and included an approach to language that traced the meanings of individual words to the objects to which they referred (see 1843, 1, 2, sec. 5). Mill’s empiricism led him to think that for meaning to have any significance for our thought and understanding, we must explain it in terms of our experience. Thus, meaning should ultimately be understood in terms of words standing for sets of sense impressions. Not all those concerned with language shared Mill’s empiricist leanings, though most shared his sense that denotation, rather than connotation, should be at the center of an account of meaning. A word denotes something by standing for it, as my name stands for me, or “Baltimore” stands for a particular city on America’s East Coast; a word connotes something when it “implies an attribute” in Mill’s terms, as “professor” generally implies an expert in an academic field and someone with certain sorts of institutional authority. For most expressions, philosophers thought that to grasp their meaning was to know what they stood for, as we often think of proper names serving simply as labels for the things they denote. (Mill also tended to use “meaning” in talking about connotation, and might have reservations with saying that proper names had “meanings,” though this is not to deny that they denote things.) Thus,

(1) The cat sat on the refrigerator.

should be understood as a complex arrangement of signs. “The cat” denotes or refers to a particular furry domesticated quadruped, “the refrigerator” denotes something, and so forth. Some further elaboration would be needed for verbs, logical vocabulary and other categories of terms, but most philosophers took the backbone of an account of meaning to be denotation, and language use to be a process of the management of signs. These signs might denote objects directly, or they might do so indirectly by standing for something within our minds, following Locke, who described words as “signs of ideas” (1690, III, 1).

Accounts that emphasized the reference of terms as constitutive of the meaning of most expressions faced two serious problems, however. First, they failed to explain the possibility of non-referring terms and negative existential sentences. On such a referential picture of meaning, the meaning of most expressions would simply be their bearers, so an existential sentence like

(2) John Coltrane plays saxophone.

was easy to analyze. Its subject term, “John Coltrane,” referred to a particular person and the sentence says of him that he does a particular sort of thing: he plays saxophone. But what of a sentence like

(3) Phlogiston was thought to be the cause of combustion.

Assuming that there is not and never was such a thing as phlogiston, how can we understand such a sentence? If the meaning of those expressions is their referent, then this sentence should strike us as meaningless. Meinong (1904) suggested that such expressions denote entities that “subsist,” but do not exist, by which he granted them a sort of reality, albeit one outside the actual universe. The majority of philosophers treated this with suspicion. Others suggested that the expression above denotes the concept or idea of “phlogiston.” The difficulty facing such responses comes into sharper relief with consideration of negative existentials.

(4) Atlantis does not exist.

If Atlantis does not exist, the expression “Atlantis” does not refer to anything and would have no meaning. One could say that “Atlantis” refers not to a sunken city, but to our concept of a sunken city. But this has the paradoxical result of making (4) false, since the concept is there for us to refer to, thus rendering it impossible to deny. This might even entail that we could not truthfully deny the existence of anything of which we could conceive, which seems implausible.

The second serious problem for referential theories of meaning, noted by Frege (1892), was the informativeness of some identity sentences. Sentences of self-identity are true purely in virtue of their logical form, and we may affirm them even when we do not know what the expression refers to. For instance, anyone could affirm

(5) Mt. Kilimanjaro is Mt. Kilimanjaro.

even if they do not know what Mt. Kilimanjaro is. Making this statement in such a case would not inform our understanding of the world in any significant way. However, a sentence like

(6) Mt. Kilimanjaro is the tallest mountain in Africa.

would certainly be informative to those who first heard it. But remember that according to referential theories of meaning, “Mt. Kilimanjaro” and “the tallest mountain in Africa” refer to the same thing and hence mean the same thing according to these theories; therefore, (5) and (6) say the same thing and one should be no more or less informative than the other. Where we grasp the meaning of an expression or a sentence, philosophers have traditionally taken it that this should make some sort of cognitive difference, for example, we should be able to perform an action, make an inference, recognize something, and so on. Thus differences in the meanings of expressions should be reflected by some difference in cognitive significance between the expressions. But if expressions refer to the same thing, and their meaning consists solely in their picking out a referent, then there should be no such cognitive difference even if there is apparently a difference in meaning. Simple referential theories do not offer us an obvious solution to this problem and therefore fail to capture important intuitions about meaning.

b. Frege on Sense and Reference

To address these problems, Frege proposed that we should think of expressions as having two semantic aspects: a sense and a reference. The sense of an expression would be its “mode of presentation,” as Frege put it, that conveyed information to us in its own distinct way. That information would in turn determine a referent for each expression. This led to a credo pervasive in analytical philosophy: sense determines reference. This solved problems of reference by shifting the emphasis to the sense of expressions first and to their reference later. Negative existential sentences were intelligible because the sense of an expression like “largest prime number” or “Atlantis” could be logically analyzed or made explicit in terms of other descriptions, even if the set of things specified by this information was, in fact, empty. Our belief that these sentences and expressions were meaningful was a consequence of grasping their senses, even when we realized this left them without a referent. As Frege put it:

It can perhaps be granted that an expression has a sense if it is formed in a grammatically correct manner and stands for a proper name. But as to whether there is a denotation corresponding to the connotation is hereby not decided… [T]he grasping of a sense does not with certainty warrant a corresponding nominatum. [that is, referent] (1892: p. 153 in Beaney (1997))

The informativeness of some identity claims also became clearer. In a sentence like (5), we are simply stating self-identity, but in a sentence like (6), we express something of real cognitive significance, containing extensions of our knowledge that cannot generally be shown a priori. This would not be a trivial matter of logical form like “A=A,” but a discovery that two very different senses determined the same referent, which would suggest important conceptual connections between different ideas, inform further inferences, and thus enlighten us in various ways. Even if “Mt. Kilimanjaro” and “the tallest mountain in Africa” refer to the same thing, it would be informative to learn that they do, and we would augment our understanding of the world by learning this.

Frege also noted that expressions which shared their referents could generally be substituted for one another without changing the truth value of a sentence. For instance, “Elvis Costello” and “Declan McManus” refer to the same object, and so if “Elvis Costello was born in Liverpool” is true, so is, “Declan McManus was born in Liverpool.” Anything that we might predicate of the one, we may predicate of the other, so long as the two expressions co-refer. However, Frege realized that there were certain contexts in which this substitutability failed, or at least could not be guaranteed. For instance,

(7) Liz knows that Elvis Costello was born in Liverpool.

may be true, even when

(8) Liz knows that Declan McManus was born in Liverpool.

is false, especially in cases where Liz does not know that Elvis Costello is Declan McManus, or never learns the latter name at all. What has happened here? Note that (7) and (8) both include strings of words that could be sentences in their own right (“Elvis Costello was born in Liverpool” and “Declan McManus was born in Liverpool”). “Liz knows that…” expresses something about those propositions (namely, Liz’s attitude towards them). Frege suggested that in these cases, the reference of those embedded sentences is not a truth value, as it would customarily be, but is rather the sense of the sentence itself. Someone might grasp the sense of one sentence but not another, and hence sentences like (7) and (8) could vary in their truth values. Frege called these “indirect” contexts, and Quine would later dub such cases “opaque” contexts.

Rudolf Carnap would later replace the term “sense” with “intension” and “reference” with “extension.” Carnap’s terminology became prevalent in formal analysis of semantics by the 1950s, though it was Frege’s original insights that drove the field. Significant worries remained for the Fregean notion of sense, however. Names and other expressions in natural languages rarely have fixed sets of descriptions that are universally acknowledged as Frege’s senses would have to be. Frege might reply that he had no intention of making sense a matter of public consensus or psychological regularity, but this makes the status of a sense all the more mysterious, as well as our capacity to grasp them. Analytical philosophers of language would struggle with this for decades to come.

Still, Frege had effectively redrawn the map for philosophy. By introducing senses as a focal point of analysis, he had carved out a distinct territory for philosophical inquiry. Senses were not simply psychological entities, since they were both commonly accessible by different speakers and had a normative dimension to them, prescribing correct usage rather than simply describing performance. (See Frege (1884) for a thorough attack on psychologistic accounts of meaning.) Nor were they the causal and mechanical objects of natural science, reducible to accounts of lawlike regularity. They were entities playing a logical and cognitive role, and would be both explanatory of conceptual content and universal across natural languages, unlike the empirical details of linguistics and anthropology. Thus, there was a project for philosophy to undertake, separate from the natural sciences, and it was the logical analysis of the underlying structure of meaning. Though naturalistic concerns would be reasserted in the development of analytical philosophy, Frege’s project would come to dominate Anglo-American philosophy for much of the next century.

c. Russell

An important bridge between Frege and the English-speaking world was Bertrand Russell’s “On Denoting” (1905). Both men were mathematicians by training and shared a concern with the foundations of arithmetic. However, Russell shared a sense with some earlier philosophers that at least some expressions were meaningful in virtue of direct reference, contra Frege. Still, Russell saw the potential in Frege’s work and undertook an analysis of singular definite descriptions. These are complex expressions that purport to single out a particular referent by providing a description, for example, “the President of the USA,” or “the tallest person in this room right now.” Russell wondered how

(9) The present King of France is bald.

could be meaningful, given the absence of a present King of France. Russell’s solution was to analyze the logical role of such descriptions. Although a select few expressions referred directly to objects, most were either descriptions that picked out a referent by offering a list of properties, or disguised abbreviations of such descriptions. Russell even suggested that most proper names were abbreviated descriptions. Strictly speaking, descriptions would not refer at all; they would be quantified phrases that had or lacked extensions. What was needed was an account that could explain the meaning of descriptions in terms of the propositions that they abbreviated. Russell (1905) analyzed sentence (9) as implying three things that jointly gave us a definition of propositions involving descriptions. (A more succinct presentation comes in Russell (1919).) A sentence like “The author of Waverley was Scott” involves three logical constituents:

(10) “x wrote Waverley” is not always false (i.e at least one person wrote Waverley)

(11) “if x and y wrote Waverley , x and y are identical” is always true (that is, at most one person wrote Waverley)

(12) “if x wrote Waverley, x was Scott” is always true (that is, whoever wrote Waverley was Scott)

The first two here effectively assert the existence and uniqueness of the referent of this expression, respectively. We may generalize them and express them as a single proposition of the form “There is a term c such that Fx is true when x is c, and Fx is false when x is not c.” (Thus, F is held uniquely by c.) This asserts that there is a unique satisfier of the description given or implied by an expression, and this may be true or false depending on the expression at hand. We can then tack on an additional condition expressing whatever property is attributed to the referent (being bald, Scott, and so on) in the form “c has the property Y.” If nothing has the property F thus analyzed, (such as “being the present King of France” in (9) above) then “c has the property Y” is false, and we have a means to analyze non-denoting expressions. Such expressions are actually to be understood as quantified phrases and we may understand them as having objects over which they quantify or lacking such objects; the grasp of the logical structure of those phrases is what constitutes our understanding of them. While we grasp each of the parts abbreviated by the expression, we also understand that one of them is false—there is no unique satisfier of “the present King of France”—and thus we can understand the sentence “The present king of France is bald” even though one of its terms does not refer. That expression can have a significant occurrence once we understand it as an “incomplete” or “complex” symbol whose meaning is derived from its constituents. Most proper names, and indeed almost all expressions in a natural language, would submit to such an analysis, and Russell’s work thus kick-started analytical philosophy in the English-speaking world. (Significant contributions were also made by G.E. Moore in the fields of epistemology and ethics and hence he is often mentioned along with Russell, but Moore’s achievements are largely outside the scope of our focus here.)

2. Early Analytical Philosophy of Language

The achievements of Russell and Frege, in setting an agenda for analytical philosophers that promised to both resolve longstanding philosophical difficulties and preserve a role for philosophy on an equal footing with the natural sciences, electrified European and American academic philosophers. The following section focuses on three points of interest in the early phases of this tradition: (1) the early work of Ludwig Wittgenstein; (2) the Logical Positivists; and (3) Tarski‘s theory of truth.

a. The Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus

Ludwig Wittgenstein came to read Frege and Russell out of an interest in the foundations of mathematics and went to Cambridge to study with Russell. He studied there, but left to serve in the Austro-Hungarian army in 1914. While being held as a prisoner of war, he wrote drafts of a text that many saw as the high-water mark of early analytical philosophy, the Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus. In it, he wrote seven propositions and made extensive comments on six of them, with extensive comments on the comments, and so forth. He laid out a parsimonious and ambitious plan to systematically realize Frege and Russell’s aspirations of analyzing the logical structure of language and thought.

Through logical analysis, Wittgenstein held that we could arrive at a conception of language as consisting of elementary propositions related by the now-familiar elements of first-order logic. Any sentence with a sense could have that sense perspicuously rendered in such a system, and any sentence that did not yield to such analysis would not have a sense at all. “Everything that can be thought at all can be thought clearly. Everything that can be said can be said clearly.” (1922, §4.116) Wittgenstein’s claim here is not that we cannot string together words in unclear ways; indeed, we do that all the time. Rather, in doing so, we do not express anything that has a sense. What we say may get nods of approval from fellow speakers, and we may even be grasping at something important, but what we say does not convey anything meaningful.

In part, this reflects Wittgenstein’s early view that propositions “pictured” the world. This is not to say that a written inscription or a verbal utterance of a sentence visually resembles that state of affairs it expresses. “Elvin Jones played drums for John Coltrane” looks like neither Elvin Jones, nor John Coltrane, nor a drum set. Rather, the form of a proposition resembled the form of some fact of the world. What was required to understand this as a picture of the world was just what was needed in the case of actual pictures—a coordination of the elements in the picture with objects outside itself. (Logical truths would be true in virtue of relations among their propositions.) Where we could do this, the language was stating something clearly; where we could not, despite our best efforts, the words were not saying anything at all. However, this was not to say that everything about meaning and our understanding of the world was a matter of explicit definition, that is, something we could say. Rather than being said with our language, many things can only be shown. For instance, think of a logical expression like “and.” Any attempt to explain its sense, like putting two things side by side, or using another term like “both,” only recapitulates the structure of “and,” thus adding nothing. The form of our propositions shows how it works and we cannot say anything more informative about it. Wittgenstein also espoused a number of views at the end of the Tractatus on solipsism, the will, and ethics, and what could be said about them; but these remain some of the most difficult and contested points of interpretation in his work. Wittgenstein took himself to have prescribed the limits of what philosophy could say, and he closed the Tractatus without further comment by saying, “Whereof we cannot speak, we must remain silent.” (1922, §7)

b. The Vienna Circle and the Logical Positivists

Beginning in 1907, a group of European professors originally known as the Ernst Mach Society began to meet regularly for discussions on matters of logic, philosophy and science under the guidance of Moritz Schlick. They later took to calling themselves the Vienna Circle and their ongoing conversations became the nascence of a movement known as Logical Positivism, which would include Carl Hempel, Rudolf Carnap, and Hans Reichenbach, among many others. They rejected the Hegelian idealism prevalent in European academic circles, espoused the austere precision of science, particularly physics, as a model for their methods, and took the phenomenalist strains of British empiricism as a more suitable epistemological foundation for such goals. Carnap adopted the insights of Frege’s work and brought tremendous sophistication to the analytical enterprise, particularly in his The Logical Structure of the World (1928). The Logical Positivists also took inspiration from Wittgenstein’s Tractatus, but their fidelity to his more abstruse aims is tenuous at best. They shared Wittgenstein’s view that logical proofs were true in virtue of internal relations among their propositions, not by virtue of any actual facts about the world, and parsed this as support for a renewed version of the analytic/synthetic distinction. Analytic sentences were those true solely in virtue of the meanings of their constituent expressions (“All bachelors are unmarried”) while synthetic sentences were true partly in virtue of empirical facts beyond the meanings of their constituent terms (“Flynn is a bachelor”). Analytic sentences would be confirmed by logical analysis, while synthetic sentences would be confirmed by appeal to observation sentences, or to sense-data in even more rigorous accounts.

This led the Positivists to the Verificationist Theory of Meaning. Analytic sentences would be true in virtue of the meanings of their terms, while all synthetic sentences would have to admit to some sort of empirical verification criteria. Any sentence that could not be verified by one or the other of these means was deemed meaningless. This excluded claims with mystical or occult import, but also large areas of ethics and metaphysics as practiced by many philosophers. Schlick (1933) put it boldly, saying:

[A] proposition has a statable meaning only if it makes a verifiable difference whether it is true or false. A proposition which is such that the world remains the same whether it is true or false simply says nothing about the world; it is empty and communicates nothing; I can give it no meaning. We have a verifiable difference, however, only when it is a difference in the given… (Ayer 1959, p. 88)

By “given” here, Schlick alluded to the stream of sense-data that come before us. Few if any sentences were understood in such ways by most speakers, so the work of philosophy was logical analysis and definition of the concepts of the natural sciences into verificationist terms. While one could imagine empirical verification of many things in the physical sciences (for example, laboratory results, predictions with observable consequences), it would be far more difficult in fields like psychology and ethics. In these cases, the Positivists favored a type of logical reductionism for the pertinent sentences in the discourse. All sentences and key concepts in psychology would be reduced to empirically verifiable sentences about the behavior of thinking subjects, for instance. A sentence about a mental state like anger would be reduced to sentences about observable behavior such as raising one’s voice, facial expressions, becoming violent, and so on. This would require “bridge laws” or sentences of theoretical identity to equate the entities of, say, psychology with the entities of the physical sciences and thus translate the terms of older theories into new ones. (Again, in some cases the preferred mode would be to equate them directly with sense-data.) Where this could not be done, the Positivists took it that the sentences in question were meaningless, and they advocated the elimination of many canonical concepts, sentences and theories, derisively lumped under the term “metaphysics.” A sentence like “God exists outside of space and time” was certainly not true in virtue of the meanings of its terms and did not admit to any sort of empirical test, so it would be dismissed as gibberish.

The Verificationist theory of meaning ran into great difficulty almost immediately, often due to objections among the Positivists. For one, any sentence stating the theory itself was neither analytical, nor subject to empirical verification, so it would seem to be either self-refuting or meaningless. Universal generalizations including scientific laws like “All electrons have a charge of 1.6×10^-19 coulombs” were also problematic, since they were not deducible from finite sets of observation sentences. (See Hempel (1950), esp. §2.1) Counterfactual sentences, such as “If we dropped this sugar cube in water, it would dissolve,” present similar problems. Efforts at refinement continued, though dissatisfaction with the whole program was growing by mid-century.

c. Tarski’s Theory of Truth

In two seminal works (1933 and 1944), Alfred Tarski made a great leap forward for the rigorous analysis of meaning, showing that semantics could be treated just as systematically as syntax could. Syntax, the rules and structures governing the recombination of words and phrases into sentences, had been analyzed with some success by logicians, but semantic notions like “meaning” or “truth” defied such efforts for many years.

Tarski sought an analysis of the concept of truth that would contain no explicit or implicit appeals to inherently semantic notions, and offered a definition of it in terms of syntax and set theory. He began by distinguishing metalanguage and object language; an object language is the language (natural or formal) that is our target for analysis, while the metalanguage is the language in which we conduct our analysis. Metalanguage is the language that we use to study another language, and the object language is the language that we study. For instance, children learning a second language typically take classes conducted in their mother tongue that treat the second language as an object to be studied. Thus, copies of all the sentences of the object language should be included in the metalanguage and the metalanguage should include sufficient resources to describe the syntax of the object language, as well. In effect, an object language would not contain its own truth predicate—this could only occur in a metalanguage, since it requires speakers to talk about sentences themselves, rather than actually to use them. There is great controversy about the shape that a metalanguague would have to take to enable analysis of a natural language, and Tarski openly doubted that these methods would transfer easily from formal to natural languages, but we will not delve into these issues here.

Tarski argued that a definition of truth would have to be “formally correct” or as he put it:

(14) For all x, True(x) iff Fx.

or a sentence provably equivalent to this, where “true” was not part of F. This much was a largely formal condition, but Tarski added a more robust call for “material adequacy” or a sense that our definition had succeeded in capturing the sorts of correspondence between states of affairs and sentences classically associated with truth. So, for instance, our truth definition had to imply a sentence like:

(15) “Snow is white” is true iff snow is white.

Note that the quotes here make the first half of this metalanguage sentence about the object language sentence “Snow is white”; the second half of the metalanguage sentence is about snow itself. Tarski then offered a definition of truth

“A sentence is true if it is satisfied by all objects and false otherwise.” (1944, p. 353)

where satisfaction is a relation between arbitrary objects and sentential functions, and sentential functions are expressions with a formal structure much like ordinary sentences, but which contain free variables, for example, “x is blue” or “x is greater than y.” Tarski thought we might indicate which objects satisfied the simplest sentential functions and then offer a further set of conditions under which compound functions were satisfied in terms of those simple functions. (Further refinements were made to a 1956 edition of the paper to accommodate certain features of model theory that we will not discuss here.) Once Tarksi added an inductive definition of the other operators of first-order logic, a definition of truth had apparently been given without appeal to inherently semantic notions, though Field (1972) would argue that “designation” and “satisfaction” were semantic notions as well. Whether this should be read as a deflationary account of truth or an analysis of a robust correspondence theory was a point of great debate among analytical philosophers, but much like Frege’s earlier work, it played the far more momentous role of convincing further generations of logicians and philosophers that the analysis of traditionally intractable philosophical notions with the tools of modern logic was both within their grasp and immensely rewarding.

3. Mid-century Revolutions

By the middle of the 20^th century, the approach spawned by Frege, Moore and Russell had taken root with the Logical Positivists. The Second World War did a great deal to scatter the most talented philosophers from the Continent, and many settled at universities in Great Britain and the United States, spreading their views and influencing generations of philosophers to come. However, the analytical tradition always had a robust streak of criticism from within, and some of the pillars of the early orthodoxy were already under some suspicion from members of the Vienna Circle like Otto Neurath (see his (1933)) and gadflies like Karl Popper. The next section addresses the work of two figures, Quine and the later Wittgenstein, who challenged received views in the philosophy of language and served as transitional figures for contemporary views.

a. Quine and the Analytic/Synthetic Distinction

W.V.O. Quine (1953) went after the very core of Logical Positivism, and in effect analytical philosophy, by attacking the analytic/synthetic distinction. The Positivists had been happy to admit a distinction between sentences that were true in virtue of the meanings of their terms and those that were true in virtue of the facts, but Quine brought a certain skepticism about the meanings of individual expressions to the table. Much like the Positivists, he was wary of anything that would not admit to empirical confirmation and saw meaning as one more such item.

Quine dismissed the idea of a meaning as a real item somehow present in our minds beyond the ways in which it manifests itself in our behavior. He later dubbed this “the myth of the museum”—a place “in which the exhibits are the meanings and the words are the labels.” (1969, p. 27) In a strongly empiricist spirit, he argued that we have no access to such things in our experience, thus they could not explain our linguistic behavior, and therefore they had no rightful place in our account. Quine wondered whether there was a principled distinction between analytic and synthetic statements at all. In reviewing the prevailing ideas of analyticity, he found each one inadequate or question-begging. Analyticity was a dogma, an article of faith among empiricists (especially Logical Positivists) and one that could not stand closer scrutiny. Moreover, the Positivists paired analyticity with a second dogma, empirical reductionism, the view that each sentence or expression could be assigned its own distinctive slice of empirical content from our experience. Quine’s claim was not that we should not be empiricists or worry about such empirical content, but rather that no individual sentence or expression could be allotted such content all on its own. The sentences of our language operate in conjunction with one another to “face the tribunal of experience” as a whole. This holism entailed a certain egalitarianism among the sentences to which we commit ourselves, as well. Any claim could be held true, come what may, if we were willing to revise other parts of our “web of belief” to accommodate it, and any claim—even one we took to be a claim about meaning before, like “all bachelors are unmarried”—could be revised if conditions demanded it. (1953, p.43) Some sentences would have a relatively strong immunity from revision, for example, the laws of logic, but they enjoy that status only because of their centrality in our present ways of thinking. Other, less central claims could be revised more easily, perhaps with only passing interest, for example, claims about the number of red brick houses on Elm St. This wide-open revisability came to set a tone for epistemology in analytical philosophy during the latter half of the 20^th century.

Without tidy parcels of empirical content or analytic truths to anchor an account of meaning, Quine saw little use for meaning at all. Instead, his work focused on co-reference and assent among speakers. In Word and Object (1960), he suggested that our position as speakers is much like that of a field linguist attempting to translate a newly discovered language with no discernible connections to other local languages. He dubbed this approach “radical translation.” Faced with such a situation, we would search for recurring expressions and attempt to secure referents for them. In his classic example, we stand around with the locals, notice that rabbits occasionally run by and that the locals mutter “Gavagai” when the rabbits pass; we might be moved by this to translate their utterances as our own word “rabbit.” Thinking of the translatability of one utterance with another thus achieves the same sort of theory-building effect that talk of shared meaning did, but without appeal to abstract objects like meanings. However, this also led to Quine’s thesis of the “indeterminacy of translation.” When we form such hypotheses based on observations of speakers’ behavior, that evidence always underdetermines our hypothesis, and the evidence could be made to fit other translations, even if they start to sound a bit strange to us. Hence, “gavagai” might also be translated as “dinner” (if the locals eat rabbits) or “Lo, an undetached rabbit part!” We might narrow the plausible translations a bit with further observation, though not to the logical exclusion of all others. Direct queries of the local speakers might also winnow the set of plausible translations a bit, but this presumes a command of a great deal of abstract terminology that we share with those speakers, and this command would presumably rest upon a shared understanding of the simpler sorts of vocabulary with which we started. Hence, nothing that we can observe about those speakers will completely determine the correctness of one translation over all competitors and translation is always indeterminate. This is not to say that we should not prefer some translations over others, but our grounds for doing so are usually pragmatic concerns about simplicity and efficiency, We should also note that each speaker is in much the same position when it comes to understanding other speakers even in her mother tongue; we have only the observable behaviors of other speakers and familiarity with our own usage of such terms, and we must make ongoing assessments of other speakers in conversation in just these ways. Donald Davidson, Quine’s student, would continue to develop these ideas even further in Quine’s wake. Davidson emphasized that the interpretations we create of the expressions in our native language are no less radical than what Quine was suggesting of the field linguist’s attempted translations of radically new expressions (see his 1984).

Quine’s work inspired many, but also came under sharp attack. The behaviorism at the heart of his account has fallen out of favor with the majority of philosophers and cognitive scientists. Much of Noam Chomsky’s (1959) critique of B.F Skinner may be said to apply to Quine’s work. The emphasis on innateness and tacit knowledge in Chomsky’s work has been subject to intense criticism as well, but this criticism has not pointed philosophers and linguists back towards the sort of strongly behaviorist empiricism on which Quine’s account was founded. Still, most contemporary philosophers of language owe some debt to Quine for dismantling the dogmas of early analytical philosophy and opening new avenues of inquiry.

b. The Later Wittgenstein

Wittgenstein left Cambridge in the early 1920s and pursued projects outside academia for several years. He returned in 1929 and began doing very different sorts of work. It is a matter of great debate, even among Wittgenstein acolytes, how much affinity there is between these stages. Many philosophers of language will speak of “the later Wittgenstein” as though the earlier views were wholly different and incompatible, while others insist that there is strong continuity of themes and methods. Though his early work was widely misunderstood at the time, there can be little doubt that some important changes took place, and these are worth noting here.

In the posthumously published Philosophical Investigations (1953), Wittgenstein broke with some of the theoretical aspirations of analytical philosophy in the first half of the century. Where analytical philosophers of language had strived for elegant, parsimonious logical systems, the Investigations suggested that language was a diverse, mercurial collection of “language games”—goal-directed social activities for which words were just so many tools to get things done, rather than fixed and eternal components in a logical structure. Representation, denotation and picturing were some of the goals that we might have in playing a language game, but they were hardly the only ones. This turn in Wittgenstein’s philosophy ushered in a new concern for the “pragmatic” dimensions of language usage. To speak of the pragmatic significance of an expression in this sense is to consider how grasping it might be manifested in actions, or the guiding of actions, and thus to turn our attention to usage rather than abstract notions of logical form common to earlier forms of analytical philosophy. (Speech act theorists will also distinguish between pragmatics and semantics in a slightly more restrictive sense, as we shall see in §4.2.) The view that “meaning is use” (1953, p.43) was often attributed to him, though interpretations of this view have varied widely. Wright (1980 and 2001) read this as a call to social conventionalism about meaning, McDowell (1984) explicitly rejected such a conclusion and Brandom (1994) took it as an entry point into an account of meaning that is both normative and pragmatic (that is, articulated in terms of obligations and entitlements to do things in certain ways according to shared practices). But it can be safely said that Wittgenstein rejected a picture of language as a detached, logical sort of picturing of the facts and inserted a concern for its pragmatic dimensions. One cannot look at the representational dimension of language alone and expect to understand what meaning is.

A second major development in the later Wittgenstein’s work was his treatment of rules and rule-following. Meaning claims had a certain hold over our actions, but not the sort that something like a law of nature would. Claims about meaning reflect norms of usage and Wittgenstein argued that this made the very idea of a “private language” absurd. By this, he means it would not be possible to have a language whose meanings were accessible to only one person, the speaker of that language. Much of modern philosophy was built on Cartesian models that grounded public language on a foundation of private episodes, which implied that much (perhaps all) of our initial grasp of language would also be private. The problem here, said Wittgenstein, is that to follow a rule for the use of an expression, appeal to something private will not suffice. Thus, a language intelligible to only one person would be impossible because it would be impossible for that speaker to establish the meanings of its putative signs.

If a language were private, then the only way to establish meanings would be by some form of private ostension, for example, concentrating on one’s experiences and privately saying, “I shall call this sensation ‘pain’.” But to establish a sign’s meaning, something must impress upon the speaker a way of correctly using that sign in the future, or else the putative ostension is of no value. Assuming we began with such a private episode, what could be happening on subsequent uses of the term? We cannot simply say that it feels the same to us as it did before, or strikes us the same way, for those sorts of impressions are common even when we make errors and therefore cannot constitute correctness. One might say that one only has to remember how one used the sign in the past, but this still leaves us wondering. What is one remembering in that case? Until we say how a private episode could establish a pattern of correct usage, memory is beside the point. To alleviate this difficulty, Wittgenstein turned his attention to the realm of public phenomena, and suggested that those who make the same moves with the rules share a “lebensform” or “form of life,” which most have taken to be one’s culture or the sum total of the social practices in which one takes part. Kripke (1982) offered a notable interpretation of Wittgenstein’s private language argument, though opinions vary on its fidelity to Wittgenstein’s work. Subsequent generations of philosophers on both sides of the Atlantic would be profoundly influenced by this argument and struggle with its implications for decades to come.

4. Major Areas in the Contemporary Field

After the seminal works of Quine and Wittgenstein at mid-century, the majority of views expressed in the field may be broadly lumped into two groups: those emphasizing truth conditions for sentences in a theory of meaning and those emphasizing use. Truth-conditional theories continue the formal analysis of Frege, Carnap and Tarski, minus Positivism’s more radical assumptions, while use theories and speech act theory take Wittgenstein’s emphasis on the pragmatic to heart. A brief overview of major figures and issues in each of these follows.

a. Truth-Conditional Theories of Meaning

The majority of philosophers of language working in the analytical tradition share Frege’s intuition that we know the meaning of a word when we know the role it plays in a sentence and we know the meaning of a sentence when we know the conditions under which it would be true. Davidson (1967) and Lewis (1972) argued for such an approach and stand as watersheds in its development. Truth-conditional theories generally begin with the assumption that something is a language or a linguistic expression if and only if its significant parts can represent the facts of the world. Sentences represent facts or states of affairs in the world, names refer to objects, and so forth. The central focus of a theory of meaning remains sentences though, since it is sentences that apparently constitute the most basic units of information. For instance, an utterance of the name “John Coltrane” does not seem to say anything until we point to someone and say, “This is John Coltrane” or assert “John Coltrane was born in North Carolina” and so on. This view of the sentence as the most basic units of meaning is compatible with compositionality, the view that sentences are composed of a finite stock of simpler elements that may be reused and recombined in novel ways, so long as we understand the meanings of those subsentential expressions as contributions to the meanings of sentences. We might understand names and other referring expressions as “picking out” their referents, to which the rest of a sentence attributes something, very roughly speaking. Truth-conditional theories of meaning have also been attractive to those who would prefer a naturalistic and reductionist semantics, appealing to nothing outside the natural world as an explainer of meaning. Strongly naturalistic accounts are also given by Evans (1983), Devitt (1981), and Devitt and Sterelny (1999).

Much attention in this area in the last twenty-five years has been directed at theories of reference, given the importance of explicating their contribution to truth-theoretical accounts. The view, often attributed to Frege, that the sense of proper names was a function of a set of descriptions led many philosophers seeking a truth-conditional account to include such descriptions in the truth conditions for sentences in which they occurred as a means of explaining their reference. However, a new wave of interest in more direct forms of reference began in the 1970s. The enthusiasm for this approach grew out of Kripke’s Naming and Necessity (1980) and a series of articles by Hilary Putnam. (1973 and 1975) There, they attacked the notion that identity statements expressed synonymies, known a priori at the time of their introduction. If we (or whoever introduces the term) stipulate that Aristotle is the author of Nicomachean Ethics, tutor of Alexander, and so on, it would seem to be known a priori that this was true of the referent of that name. The referent is just that thing which satisfies all or most of the “cluster of descriptions” that express the sense of that name. But if we discovered that much or all of this was false of the person we had called “Aristotle,” would this imply that Aristotle did not exist, or that someone else was Aristotle? Much the same could be said of natural kind terms: we took whales to be fish, but those big cetaceans have lungs and mammary glands, so are there no whales after all?

Instead, Putnam and Kripke suggested that proper names and natural kind terms (and descriptions like “the square root of 289”) were rigid designators, or expressions that referred to the same objects or kinds in every possible world without that relation being mediated by some form of descriptive content. Other pieces of descriptive content are actually associated with those expressions—we do say that Aristotle wrote Nicomachean Ethics and that whales are mammals, and so on—but their reference is fixed at the time of their introduction and our use preserves that reference, not the descriptive content. The descriptions associated with a rigid designator (“the author of Nicomachean Ethics,” and so on) are thus always revisable. This has been seen as a form of externalism in semantics, whereby the meanings of words are not entirely determined by psychological states of the speakers who use them, or as Putnam famously quipped, “meanings just ain’t in the head” (1975, p. 227). Notable recent works in this field include Kitcher and Stanford (2000), Soames (2002) and Berger (2002). Several accounts have suggested that while rigid designation in itself has some plausibility, the reductionist elements of these theories leave us with an implausibly direct and unmediated account of reference that must be refined or replaced (Dummett (1974), MacBeth (1995) and Wolf (2006)).

b. Meaning and Use

Verificationist theories fell out of favor after Quine, but were reinvigorated by Michael Dummett’s work on meaning and logic as well as his extensive exegetical work on Frege. (See his 1963, 1974, 1975 and 1976.) Dummett shared the Positivists’ concern with the cognitive significance of a statement, which he interpreted as Frege’s real concern in talking about sense in the first place. Many read Frege as a Platonist about meaning, but Dummett challenged the need for such ontological extensions and their plausibility as explainers of semantic facts in general. Dummett’s position was less a product of a priori ontological stinginess than a continuation of Wittgensteinian themes. Dummett argued that a model of meaning is a model of our understanding when we know such meanings. We are sometimes able to express this understanding explicitly, but a model of meaning could not include such a criterion of explicitness on pain of an infinite regress. (Note Wittgenstein’s Private Language Argument on this point.) Thus, the knowledge that generally constitutes understanding must be implicit knowledge and we can only ascribe such implicit knowledge when we have some sort of observable criteria by which to do so. These observable criteria will be matters of the use of sentences and expressions. (See Dummett 1973, pp. 216ff.)

While such a mix of usage and verification may be straightforward for sentences and conditions that occasionally obtain, it is quite another matter in cases in which they do not. We can grasp the meaning of a sentence whose truth conditions never actually obtain or can never (practically speaking) be verified, for example, “every even number is the sum of two primes.” Knowing what it is for some condition to obtain and knowing that a particular case exemplifies this are separable conditions, so meaning cannot be the simple verification of placing someone in a certain condition and seeing what sentences they utter. Dummett expanded his account by the inclusion of conditions like providing correct inferential consequences of a sentence, correct novel use of a sentence and judgments about sufficient or probable evidence for the truth or falsity of a sentence. He maintains that some form of self-verifying presentations will support these demands and allow us to derive all the features of language use and meaning, though this remains a sticking point for many who are skeptical of such episodes and epistemic foundationalism in general.

Dummett’s reading of Wittgenstein’s emphasis on use has not been the only one, though. Following Sellars (1967), theorists like Harman (1982 and 1987), Block (1986 and 1987), and Brandom (1994) have all pursued an “inferential role” or “conceptual role” semantics that characterized a grasp of the meaning of sentences as a grasp of the inferences one would make to and from that sentence. Block and Harman have explicitly taken this as a basis of a functionalist account of mental content in psychology, as well. Brandom has not pursued such causal explanatory strategies, but instead has emphasized the rational dimension of linguistic competence and the importance of inference to such an account. We grasp the meaning of a sentence when we understand other sentences as relevant to it and infer to and from them in the course of giving and asking for reasons for the claims that we make. A substantial extension of this work, offering a robustly normative account of meaning in sharp contrast to the causal reductionism mentioned above, is offered in Lance and O’Leary-Hawthorne (1997).

c. Speech Act Theory and Pragmatics

Wittgenstein’s later work sparked interest in the pragmatic dimensions of language use among some British philosophers working not long after his death, but a number grew exasperated with the more deflationary and “ordinary language” approaches of Wittgenstein’s acolytes, who saw almost no role for theoretical accounts in describing language at all. Some opted instead to pursue what has come to be known as speech act theory, led initially by the work of John Austin. (See Grice (1975), Austin (1962) and Searle (1969).) These philosophers sought an account of language by which sentences were tools for doing things, including a taxonomy of uses to which pieces of the language could be put. While conventional meaning remained important, speech act theorists extended their focus to an examination of the different ways in which utterances and inscriptions of sentences might play a role in achieving various goals. For instance, the sentence

(16) It is sunny outside.

could be a report, an admonition not to take an umbrella, a lie (if it’s not sunny), practicing English, a taunt and many other things depending on the scenario in which it is put to use.

To see clearly how speech act theorists might address these issues, we should take note of one of its central doctrines, the pragmatics/semantics distinction. We may state this generally by saying that semantic information pertains to linguistic expressions (such as words and sentences), while pragmatic information pertains to utterances and the facts surrounding them. The study of pragmatics thus includes no attention to features like truth or the reference of words and expressions, but it does include attention to information about the context in which a speaker made the utterance and how those conditions allow the speaker to express one proposition rather than another. This strongly contextual element of pragmatics often leads to special attention to the goals that a speaker might achieve by uttering a sentence in a particular way in that context and why she might have done so. Thus, what a speaker means in saying something is often explained by an emphasis on the speaker’s intentions: to reveal to the hearer that the speaker wants the hearer to respond in a certain way and thus to get the hearer to respond in this way. However, there may be cases in which these intentions have nothing to do with the meaning of the sentence. I might say, “It is raining outside,” with the intention of getting you to take your umbrella, but that’s not what the sentence means. Likewise, I might have said, “The Weather Channel is predicting rain this afternoon,” with those intentions, but this does not entail that those two sentences mean the same thing.

Those intentions whose success is entirely a matter of getting a hearer’s recognition of the actual intention itself are called illocutionary intentions; those intentions whose success is entirely a matter of getting the hearer to do something (above and beyond understanding the semantic content of what is said) are called perlocutionary intentions. Perlocutionary intentions must be achieved through illocutionary acts, for example, making you aware of my intentions to get you to realize something about the weather leads you to think of your umbrella and take it. Following Bach and Harnish (1979), speech act theorists typically characterize speech acts by four analytical subcomponents of speech acts: (1) utterance acts, that is, the very voicing or inscribing of words and sentences; (2) propositional acts, that is, referring to things and predicating properties and relations of them; (3) illocutionary acts, by which speakers interact with other speakers and the utterances constitute moves in that interaction, for example, promises and commands; and (4) perlocutionary acts, by which speakers bring about or achieve something in others by what they say, for example, convincing or persuading someone. Some theorists would also add “meaning intention” and “communicative intention” to this list to emphasize shared understanding of the conventional meanings attached with words and the intersubjectivity of speech acts. As these categories might imply, speech act theory has also incorporated far more consideration of conversational features of discourse and the social aspects of communications than other branches of the philosophy of language. For this reason, it offers promising points of connection between sophisticated semantic accounts and the empirical research of social scientists.

Grice (1975) also suggested that philosophy must consider the ways in which speakers go beyond what is strictly, overtly said by their utterances to consider what is contextually implicated by them. By “implicated,” here, we are considering the ways in which the things a speaker says may invite another speaker to some further set of conclusions, but not in the strict logical sense of entailment or a purely formal matter of conventional meanings. Grice divided these implicatures into two large categories: conventional implicatures and conversational implicatures. Conventional implicatures are those assigned to utterances based on the conventional meanings of the words used, though not in the ways familiar from ordinary logical entailments. For instance:

(17) Michael is an Orioles fan, but he doesn’t live in Baltimore.

(18) Michael is an Orioles fan, and he doesn’t live in Baltimore.

(19) Michael’s being an Orioles fan is unexpected, given that he doesn’t live in Baltimore.

Here, (19) is implied by (17), but not by (18). This failure is not a matter of differences in what makes (17) and (18) true, but in the way in which conventions and conversational principles allow speakers to convey such information. Roughly, the word “but” is used by English speakers to emphasize contrast and surprise, as a speaker would in saying (17).

Conversational implicatures are assigned based on a series of maxims and assumptions by which speakers in conversation cooperate with one another, according to Grice. He suggests maxims of quantity (make your contribution informative but not excessively so), quality (make your contribution true), relation (be relevant), and manner (be perspicuous). To get a sense of how to apply these, consider one of Grice’s (1975) examples:

(20) Smith doesn’t seem to have a girlfriend these days.

(21) He has been paying a lot of visits to New York lately.

Imagine two people having a conversation, with A saying (20) and B saying (21). B implicates that Smith might have a girlfriend in New York, assuming that B is following the maxims mentioned above. If not, say, because B is saying something false or irrelevant, then speakers cannot cooperate and communication collapses. Grice contends that these conversational implicatures are calculable given the right sorts of contextual and background information, along with the linguistic meaning of what is said and the speakers’ adherence to the cooperative maxims described earlier, and much of the literature on conversational implicature has attempted to make good on this notion. Many philosophers working on these aspects of pragmatics worry that these maxims will not suffice as an account of implicature however, and readers should consult Davis (1998) for the most current set of objections to classic Gricean accounts.

Attention to both forms of implicature has drawn philosophers’ attention to matters of presupposition, as well. As the name would suggest, the discussion of this subject focuses on the sorts of information required as background for various sorts of logical and conversational features to obtain. The well-worn example, “Have you stopped robbing liquor stores?” presupposes that you have been robbing liquor stores. Implicatures of both forms thus involve various sorts of presupposition, for example the conventional implicature of “but” in (17) presupposes a proposition about the demographics of Orioles fans, and much recent work in pragmatics has been devoted to developing typologies of presupposition at work in conversation. The two most serious questions for theorists are (1) how presuppositions are introduced into or “triggered” in the sentences in which they play a role and (2) how they are “projected” or carried from the clauses and parts of sentences in which they appear up into the higher-level sentences. The origin of much of the work on this is Langendoen and Savin (1971), and a vast literature has developed in light of it in linguistics and formal semantics.

5. Future Directions and Emerging Debates

While linguistic analysis does not dominate thinking in analytical philosophy as it did for much of the twentieth century, it remains a vibrant field that continues to develop. As in the early days of analytical philosophy, there is great interest in parallels between the content of utterances and the attribution of content to mental states, but many cognitive scientists have moved away from the classic analytical assumption that thoughts had a symbolic or sentence-like content. Following the directions mapped out in Rumelhart and McClelland (1986) some cognitive scientists have embraced connectionism, a view that emphasizes the dynamic interaction between large sets of interconnected nodules (much like neurons in the brain), as a model for cognition. Thought would thus not be symbol processing, akin to an internal monologue, and the scope of traditional accounts of language and meaning would be greatly diminished. Readers may consult Tomberlin (1995) for an overview of the field and Churchland (1995) for one of its most ardent proponents. A defense of more traditional symbol-processing approaches has also developed, notably in the work of Fodor and Lepore (1999), complemented by even more radical challenges to symbol processing in the form of dynamic systems theory (see van Gelder 1995 and Rockwell 2005).

Much recent work in the philosophy of language has also been concerned with the context sensitivity of expressions and sentences. This has been driven in no small part by an increasing emphasis on context sensitivity in epistemology (DeRose 1998; Lewis 1996) and meta-ethics (Dancy 1993). Of course, much more emphasis had been put on context over the last fifty years by use and speech act theories. Recently, some have come out in favor of context insensitivity as the predominant mode of natural languages. Cappelen and Lepore (2005) do not argue that there are no context sensitive words or sentences, but rather for semantic minimalism, the view that there are relatively few and they are familiar categories like pronouns and indexicals. They combine this with new work on speech act content to mount a substantial challenge to a great many contemporary philosophers. This debate between minimalists and contextualists promises to be a lively one in the philosophy of language over the next few years.

6. References and Further Reading

(Works are listed first by their original dates of publication, with more recent and widely available editions included in some entries.)
Austin, J. L. (1962) How To Do Things With Words. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Bach, K. and Harnish, R. (1979) Linguistic Communication and Speech Acts. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Berger, Alan. (2002) Terms and Truth: Reference Direct and Anaphoric. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Block, N. (1986) “Advertisement For a Semantics for Psychology.” In P. French, T. Uehling and H. Wettstein (Eds.). Midwest Studies in Philosophy, vol. 10, pp. 615-678. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
Block, N. (1987) “Functional Role and Truth Conditions,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 61, 157-181.
Brandom, R. (1994) Making It Explicit. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Cappelen, H. and Lepore, E. (2005) Insensitive Semantics. Oxford: Basil Blackwell Pub.
Carnap, R. (1928) The Logical Structure of the World (Die Logische Aufbau der Welt). George, E. (trans.) New York: Open Court Classics, 1999.
Chomsky, N. (1959) “A Review of B. F. Skinner’s Verbal Behavior.” In Language, 35(1), 26-58.
Churchland, P. (1995) Engine of Reason, Seat of the Soul: A Philosophical Journey Into the Brain. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Dancy, J. (1993) Moral Reasons. Oxford: Basil Blackwell Pub.
Davidson, D. (1967) “Truth and Meaning.” In Davidson (1984), pp. 17-36.
Davidson, D. (1984) Inquiries Into Truth and Interpretation. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Davis, W. (1998) Implicature: Intention, Convention and Principle in the Failure of Gricean Theory. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
DeRose K. (1995) “Solving the Skeptical Problem.” The Philosophical Review 104(1), 1-7, 17-52.
Devitt, Michael. (1981) Designation. New York: Columbia University Press.
Devitt, M. and Sterelny, K. (1999) Language and Reality. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Dummett, M. (1963) “Realism.” In Dummett (1978), pp. 145-165.
Dummett, M. (1973) “The Philosophical Basis of Intuitionistic Logic.” In Dummett (1978), pp. 215-247.
Dummett, M. (1974) “The Social Character of Meaning.” In Dummett (1978), pp. 420-430.
Dummett, M. (1975) “Frege’s Distinction Between Sense and Reference.” In Dummett (1978), pp. 116-144.
Dummett, M. (1976) “What Is a Theory of Meaning? (II)” In Truth and Meaning: Essays in Semantics. G. Evans and J. McDowell. (Eds.) Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Dummett, M. (1978) Truth and Other Enigmas. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Evans, G. (1983) The Varieties of Reference. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Field, H. (1972) “Tarski’s Theory of Truth.” Journal of Philosophy 69, 347-75.
Field, H. (1977) “Logic, Meaning and Conceptual Role” Journal of Philosophy 74, 379-408.
Fodor, J and E. Lepore. (1999) “All at Sea in Semantic Space: Churchland on Meaning Similarity.” Journal of Philosophy 96, 381-403.
Frege, G. (1892) “On Sense and Reference.” In The Frege Reader. Beaney, M. (Ed.) London: Penguin Press, 1997.
Frege, G. (1884) The Foundations of Arithmetic: A Logico-Mathematical Enquiry into the Concept of Number. J. Austin (Trans.) Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1980.
Grice, P. (1975) “Logic and Conversation.” In Studies in the Way of Words, pp. 22-40. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1989.
Harman, G. (1982) “Conceptual Role Semantics.” Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic 23, 242-56.
Harman, G. (1987) “(Non-solipsistic) Conceptual Role Semantics.” In New Directions in Semantics. E. Lepore. (Ed.) London: Academic Press.
Hempel, C. (1950) “Problems and Changes in the Empiricist Criterion of Meaning.” Revenue Internationale de Philosophie 11, 41-63.
Kitcher, P. and M. Stanford. (2000) “Refining the Causal Theory of Reference for Natural Kind Terms.” Philosophical Studies 97, 99-129.
Kripke, S. (1972) Naming and Necessity, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Kripke, S. (1982) Wittgenstein on Rules and Private Language. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Lance, M. and O’Leary-Hawthorne, J. (1997) The Grammar of Meaning. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Langendoen, D.T. and Savin, H.B. (1971) “The Projection Problem for Presuppositions.” In C.J. Fillmore and D.T. Langendoen (Eds.) Studies in Linguistic Semantics. New York: Holt, Reinhart and Winston.
Lewis, D. (1972) “General Semantics.” In G. Harman and D. Davidson (Eds.) Semantics of Natural Language. Dordrecht: D. Reidel Pub.
Lewis, D. (1996) “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74(4), 549-67.
Locke, J. (1690) An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. P. Nidditch. (Ed.) Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1975.
MacBeth, D. (1995) “Names, Natural Kinds and Rigid Designation.” Philosophical Studies 79, 259-281.
McDowell, J. (1984) “Wittgenstein on Following a Rule.” Synthese 58(3), 325-364.
Meinong, A. (1904) “Über Gegenstandstheorie.” In A. Meinong (ed.), Untersuchungen zur Gegenstandstheorie und Psychologie, Leipzig: Barth.
Mill, J.S. (1843) System of Logic: Ratiocinative and Inductive. Stockton, CA: University Press of the Pacific, 2002.
Neurath, O. (1933) “Protocol Sentences.” G. Shick. (Trans.) In A. Ayer (Ed.) Logical Positivism, pp. 199-208. New York: The Free Press, 1959.
Putnam, H. (1973) “Meaning and Reference.” The Journal of Philosophy 70, 699-711.
Putnam, H. (1975) “The Meaning of Meaning.” In Mind, Language and Reality, pp. 215-271. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Rockwell, T. (2005) “Attractor Spaces as Modules: A Semi-Eliminative Reduction of Symbolic AI to Dynamic Systems Theory.” Minds and Machines 15(1), 23-95.
Rumelhart, D. and McClelland, J. and the PDP Research Group. (2006) Parallel Distributed Processing: Explorations in the Microstructure of Cognition, Vol. 2: Psychological and Biological Models. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Russell, B. (1905) “On Denoting.” Mind 14, 479-493.
Russell, B. (1919) “Descriptions.” In Introduction to Mathematical Philosophy pp. 167-180. London: George Allen and Unqin Ltd.
Quine, W.V.O. (1953) “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.” In From a Logical Point of View, pp. 20-46. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Quine, W.V.O. (1960) Word and Object. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Quine, W.V.O. (1969) “Ontological Relativity.” In Ontological Relativity and Other Essays, pp 26-68. New York: Columbia University Press.
Schlick, M. (1933) “Positivism and Realism.” D. Rynin. (Trans.). In A. Ayer (Ed.) Logical Positivism, pp. 82-107. New York: The Free Press, 1959.
Searle, J. (1969) Speech Acts: An Essay in the Philosophy of Language. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
Sellars, W. (1967) Science and Metaphysics. Atascasdero, CA: Ridgeview Press.
Soames, S. (2002) Beyond Rigidity: The Unfinished Semantic Agenda of Naming and Necessity. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Tarski, A. (1933) “The concept of truth in the languages of the deductive sciences.” In A. Tarski. Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics, papers from 1923 to 1938, pp. 152-278. Corcoran, J. (Ed.). Indianapolis : Hackett Publishing Company, 1983.
Tarski, A. (1944) “The Semantic Conception of Truth and the Foundations of Semantics.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 4, 341-375
Tomberlin, J. (Ed.) (1995) Philosophical Perspectives 9: AI, Connectionism and Philosophical Psychology. Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Press.
Van Gelder, T. (1995) “What Might Cognition Be If Not Computation?” Journal of Philosophy 92, 345-381.
Wittgenstein, L. (1922) Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus. C. Ogden. (Trans.) New York: Dover Pub., 1999.
Wittgenstein, L. (1953) Philosophical Investigations: The German Text, With a Revised English Translation. Anscombe, G. and Anscombe, E. (Trans.). Oxford: Basil Blackwell Pub., 2002.
Wolf, M. (2006) “Rigid Designation and Anaphoric Theories of Reference.” Philosophical Studies 130(2), 351-375.
Wright, C. (1980). Wittgenstein on the Foundations of Mathematics. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Wright, C. (2001). Rails to Infinity. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.

Author Information

Michael P. Wolf
Email: mwolf@washjeff.edu
Washington and Jefferson College
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Sexuality

Among the many topics explored by the philosophy of sexuality are procreation, contraception, celibacy, marriage, adultery, casual sex, flirting, prostitution, homosexuality, masturbation, seduction, rape, sexual harassment, sadomasochism, pornography, bestiality, and pedophilia. What do all these things have in common? All are related in various ways to the vast domain of human sexuality. That is, they are related, on the one hand, to the human desires and activities that involve the search for and attainment of sexual pleasure or satisfaction and, on the other hand, to the human desires and activities that involve the creation of new human beings. For it is a natural feature of human beings that certain sorts of behaviors and certain bodily organs are and can be employed either for pleasure or for reproduction, or for both.

The philosophy of sexuality explores these topics both conceptually and normatively. Conceptual analysis is carried out in the philosophy of sexuality in order to clarify the fundamental notions of sexual desire and sexual activity. Conceptual analysis is also carried out in attempting to arrive at satisfactory definitions of adultery, prostitution, rape, pornography, and so forth. Conceptual analysis (for example: what are the distinctive features of a desire that make it sexual desire instead of something else? In what ways does seduction differ from nonviolent rape?) is often difficult and seemingly picky, but proves rewarding in unanticipated and surprising ways.

Normative philosophy of sexuality inquires about the value of sexual activity and sexual pleasure and of the various forms they take. Thus the philosophy of sexuality is concerned with the perennial questions of sexual morality and constitutes a large branch of applied ethics. Normative philosophy of sexuality investigates what contribution is made to the good or virtuous life by sexuality, and tries to determine what moral obligations we have to refrain from performing certain sexual acts and what moral permissions we have to engage in others.

Some philosophers of sexuality carry out conceptual analysis and the study of sexual ethics separately. They believe that it is one thing to define a sexual phenomenon (such as rape or adultery) and quite another thing to evaluate it. Other philosophers of sexuality believe that a robust distinction between defining a sexual phenomenon and arriving at moral evaluations of it cannot be made, that analyses of sexual concepts and moral evaluations of sexual acts influence each other. Whether there actually is a tidy distinction between values and morals, on the one hand, and natural, social, or conceptual facts, on the other hand, is one of those fascinating, endlessly debated issues in philosophy, and is not limited to the philosophy of sexuality.

Metaphysics of Sexuality
Metaphysical Sexual Pessimism
Metaphysical Sexual Optimism
Moral Evaluations
Nonmoral Evaluations
The Dangers of Sex
Sexual Perversion
Sexual Perversion and Morality
Aquinas’s Natural Law
Nagel’s Secular Philosophy
Fetishism
Female Sexuality and Natural Law
Debates in Sexual Ethics
Natural Law vs. Liberal Ethics
Consent Is Not Sufficient
Consent Is Sufficient
What Is “Voluntary”?
Conceptual Analysis
Sexual Activity vs. “Having Sex”
Sexual Activity and Sexual Pleasure
1. Sexual Activity Without Pleasure
References and Further Reading

1. Metaphysics of Sexuality

Our moral evaluations of sexual activity are bound to be affected by what we view the nature of the sexual impulse, or of sexual desire, to be in human beings. In this regard there is a deep divide between those philosophers that we might call the metaphysical sexual optimists and those we might call the metaphysical sexual pessimists.

The pessimists in the philosophy of sexuality, such as St. Augustine, Immanuel Kant, and, sometimes, Sigmund Freud, perceive the sexual impulse and acting on it to be something nearly always, if not necessarily, unbefitting the dignity of the human person; they see the essence and the results of the drive to be incompatible with more significant and lofty goals and aspirations of human existence; they fear that the power and demands of the sexual impulse make it a danger to harmonious civilized life; and they find in sexuality a severe threat not only to our proper relations with, and our moral treatment of, other persons, but also equally a threat to our own humanity.

On the other side of the divide are the metaphysical sexual optimists (Plato, in some of his works, sometimes Sigmund Freud, Bertrand Russell, and many contemporary philosophers) who perceive nothing especially obnoxious in the sexual impulse. They view human sexuality as just another and mostly innocuous dimension of our existence as embodied or animal-like creatures; they judge that sexuality, which in some measure has been given to us by evolution, cannot but be conducive to our well-being without detracting from our intellectual propensities; and they praise rather than fear the power of an impulse that can lift us to various high forms of happiness.

The particular sort of metaphysics of sex one believes will influence one’s subsequent judgments about the value and role of sexuality in the good or virtuous life and about what sexual activities are morally wrong and which ones are morally permissible. Let’s explore some of these implications.

2. Metaphysical Sexual Pessimism

An extended version of metaphysical pessimism might make the following claims: In virtue of the nature of sexual desire, a person who sexually desires another person objectifies that other person, both before and during sexual activity. Sex, says Kant, “makes of the loved person an Object of appetite. . . . Taken by itself it is a degradation of human nature” (Lectures on Ethics, p. 163). Certain types of manipulation and deception seem required prior to engaging in sex with another person, or are so common as to appear part of the nature of the sexual experience. As Bernard Baumrim makes the point, “sexual interaction is essentially manipulative—physically, psychologically, emotionally, and even intellectually” (“Sexual Immorality Delineated,” p. 300). We go out of our way, for example, to make ourselves look more attractive and desirable to the other person than we really are, and we go to great lengths to conceal our defects. And when one person sexually desires another, the other person’s body, his or her lips, thighs, toes, and buttocks are desired as the arousing parts they are, distinct from the person. The other’s genitals, too, are the object of our attention: “sexuality is not an inclination which one human being has for another as such, but is an inclination for the sex of another. . . . [O]nly her sex is the object of his desires” (Kant, Lectures, p. 164).

Further, the sexual act itself is peculiar, with its uncontrollable arousal, involuntary jerkings, and its yearning to master and consume the other person’s body. During the act, a person both loses control of himself and loses regard for the humanity of the other. Our sexuality is a threat to the other’s personhood; but the one who is in the grip of desire is also on the verge of losing his or her personhood. The one who desires depends on the whims of another person to gain satisfaction, and becomes as a result a jellyfish, susceptible to the demands and manipulations of the other: “In desire you are compromised in the eyes of the object of desire, since you have displayed that you have designs which are vulnerable to his intentions” (Roger Scruton, Sexual Desire, p. 82). A person who proposes an irresistible sexual offer to another person may be exploiting someone made weak by sexual desire (see Virginia Held, “Coercion and Coercive Offers,” p. 58).

Moreover, a person who gives in to another’s sexual desire makes a tool of himself or herself. “For the natural use that one sex makes of the other’s sexual organs is enjoyment, for which one gives oneself up to the other. In this act a human being makes himself into a thing, which conflicts with the right of humanity in his own person” (Kant, Metaphysics of Morals, p. 62). Those engaged in sexual activity make themselves willingly into objects for each other merely for the sake of sexual pleasure. Hence both persons are reduced to the animal level. “If . . . a man wishes to satisfy his desire, and a woman hers, they stimulate each other’s desire; their inclinations meet, but their object is not human nature but sex, and each of them dishonours the human nature of the other. They make of humanity an instrument for the satisfaction of their lusts and inclinations, and dishonour it by placing it on a level with animal nature” (Kant, Lectures, p. 164).

Finally, due to the insistent nature of the sexual impulse, once things get going it is often hard to stop them in their tracks, and as a result we often end up doing things sexually that we had never planned or wanted to do. Sexual desire is also powerfully inelastic, one of the passions most likely to challenge reason, compelling us to seek satisfaction even when doing so involves dark-alley gropings, microbiologically filthy acts, slinking around the White House, or getting married impetuously.

Given such a pessimistic metaphysics of human sexuality, one might well conclude that acting on the sexual impulse is always morally wrong. That might, indeed, be precisely the right conclusion to draw, even if it implies the end of Homo sapiens. (This doomsday result is also implied by St. Paul’s praising, in 1 Corinthians 7, sexual celibacy as the ideal spiritual state.) More frequently, however, the pessimistic metaphysicians of sexuality conclude that sexual activity is morally permissible only within marriage (of the lifelong, monogamous, heterosexual sort) and only for the purpose of procreation. Regarding the bodily activities that both lead to procreation and produce sexual pleasure, it is their procreative potential that is singularly significant and bestows value on these activities; seeking pleasure is an impediment to morally virtuous sexuality, and is something that should not be undertaken deliberately or for its own sake. Sexual pleasure at most has instrumental value, in inducing us to engage in an act that has procreation as its primary purpose. Such views are common among Christian thinkers, for example, St. Augustine: “A man turns to good use the evil of concupiscence, and is not overcome by it, when he bridles and restrains its rage . . . and never relaxes his hold upon it except when intent on offspring, and then controls and applies it to the carnal generation of children . . . , not to the subjection of the spirit to the flesh in a sordid servitude” (On Marriage and Concupiscence, bk. 1, ch. 9).

3. Metaphysical Sexual Optimism

Metaphysical sexual optimists suppose that sexuality is a bonding mechanism that naturally and happily joins people together both sexually and nonsexually. Sexual activity involves pleasing the self and the other at the same time, and these exchanges of pleasure generate both gratitude and affection, which in turn are bound to deepen human relationships and make them more emotionally substantial. Further, and this is the most important point, sexual pleasure is, for a metaphysical optimist, a valuable thing in its own right, something to be cherished and promoted because it has intrinsic and not merely instrumental value. Hence the pursuit of sexual pleasure does not require much intricate justification; sexual activity surely need not be confined to marriage or directed at procreation. The good and virtuous life, while including much else, can also include a wide variety and extent of sexual relations. (See Russell Vannoy’s spirited defense of the value of sexual activity for its own sake, in Sex Without Love.)

Irving Singer is a contemporary philosopher of sexuality who expresses well one form of metaphysical optimism: “For though sexual interest resembles an appetite in some respects, it differs from hunger or thirst in being an interpersonal sensitivity, one that enables us to delight in the mind and character of other persons as well as in their flesh. Though at times people may be used as sexual objects and cast aside once their utility has been exhausted, this is no[t] . . . definitive of sexual desire. . . . By awakening us to the living presence of someone else, sexuality can enable us to treat this other being as just the person he or she happens to be. . . . There is nothing in the nature of sexuality as such that necessarily . . . reduces persons to things. On the contrary, sex may be seen as an instinctual agency by which persons respond to one another through their bodies” (The Nature of Love, vol. 2, p. 382. See also Jean Hampton, “Defining Wrong and Defining Rape”).

Pausanias, in Plato’s Symposium (181a-3, 183e, 184d), asserts that sexuality in itself is neither good nor bad. He recognizes, as a result, that there can be morally bad and morally good sexual activity, and proposes a corresponding distinction between what he calls “vulgar” eros and “heavenly” eros. A person who has vulgar eros is one who experiences promiscuous sexual desire, has a lust that can be satisfied by any partner, and selfishly seeks only for himself or herself the pleasures of sexual activity. By contrast, a person who has heavenly eros experiences a sexual desire that attaches to a particular person; he or she is as much interested in the other person’s personality and well-being as he or she is concerned to have physical contact with and sexual satisfaction by means of the other person. A similar distinction between sexuality per se and eros is described by C. S. Lewis in his The Four Loves (chapter 5), and it is perhaps what Allan Bloom has in mind when he writes, “Animals have sex and human beings have eros, and no accurate science [or philosophy] is possible without making this distinction” (Love and Friendship, p. 19).

The divide between metaphysical optimists and metaphysical pessimists might, then, be put this way: metaphysical pessimists think that sexuality, unless it is rigorously constrained by social norms that have become internalized, will tend to be governed by vulgar eros, while metaphysical optimists think that sexuality, by itself, does not lead to or become vulgar, that by its nature it can easily be and often is heavenly. (See the entry, Philosophy of Love.)

4. Moral Evaluations

Of course, we can and often do evaluate sexual activity morally: we inquire whether a sexual act—either a particular occurrence of a sexual act (the act we are doing or want to do right now) or a type of sexual act (say, all instances of homosexual fellatio)—is morally good or morally bad. More specifically, we evaluate, or judge, sexual acts to be morally obligatory, morally permissible, morally supererogatory, or morally wrong. For example: a spouse might have a moral obligation to engage in sex with the other spouse; it might be morally permissible for married couples to employ contraception while engaging in coitus; one person’s agreeing to have sexual relations with another person when the former has no sexual desire of his or her own but does want to please the latter might be an act of supererogation; and rape and incest are commonly thought to be morally wrong.

Note that if a specific type of sexual act is morally wrong (say, homosexual fellatio), then every instance of that type of act will be morally wrong. However, from the fact that the particular sexual act we are now doing or contemplate doing is morally wrong, it does not follow that any specific type of act is morally wrong; the sexual act that we are contemplating might be wrong for lots of different reasons having nothing to do with the type of sexual act that it is. For example, suppose we are engaging in heterosexual coitus (or anything else), and that this particular act is wrong because it is adulterous. The wrongfulness of our sexual activity does not imply that heterosexual coitus in general (or anything else), as a type of sexual act, is morally wrong. In some cases, of course, a particular sexual act will be wrong for several reasons: not only is it wrong because it is of a specific type (say, it is an instance of homosexual fellatio), but it is also wrong because at least one of the participants is married to someone else (it is wrong also because it is adulterous).

5. Nonmoral Evaluations

We can also evaluate sexual activity (again, either a particular occurrence of a sexual act or a specific type of sexual activity) nonmorally: nonmorally “good” sex is sexual activity that provides pleasure to the participants or is physically or emotionally satisfying, while nonmorally “bad” sex is unexciting, tedious, boring, unenjoyable, or even unpleasant. An analogy will clarify the difference between morally evaluating something as good or bad and nonmorally evaluating it as good or bad. This radio on my desk is a good radio, in the nonmoral sense, because it does for me what I expect from a radio: it consistently provides clear tones. If, instead, the radio hissed and cackled most of the time, it would be a bad radio, nonmorally-speaking, and it would be senseless for me to blame the radio for its faults and threaten it with a trip to hell if it did not improve its behavior. Similarly, sexual activity can be nonmorally good if it provides for us what we expect sexual activity to provide, which is usually sexual pleasure, and this fact has no necessary moral implications..

It is not difficult to see that the fact that a sexual activity is perfectly nonmorally good, by abundantly satisfying both persons, does not mean by itself that the act is morally good: some adulterous sexual activity might well be very pleasing to the participants, yet be morally wrong. Further, the fact that a sexual activity is nonmorally bad, that is, does not produce pleasure for the persons engaged in it, does not by itself mean that the act is morally bad. Unpleasant sexual activity might occur between persons who have little experience engaging in sexual activity (they do not yet know how to do sexual things, or have not yet learned what their likes and dislikes are), but their failure to provide pleasure for each other does not mean by itself that they perform morally wrongful acts.

Thus the moral evaluation of sexual activity is a distinct enterprise from the nonmoral evaluation of sexual activity, even if there do remain important connections between them. For example, the fact that a sexual act provides pleasure to both participants, and is thereby nonmorally good, might be taken as a strong, but only prima facie good, reason for thinking that the act is morally good or at least has some degree of moral value. Indeed, utilitarians such as Jeremy Bentham and even John Stuart Mill might claim that, in general, the nonmoral goodness of sexual activity goes a long way toward justifying it. Another example: if one person never attempts to provide sexual pleasure to his or her partner, but selfishly insists on experiencing only his or her own pleasure, then that person’s contribution to their sexual activity is morally suspicious or objectionable. But that judgment rests not simply on the fact that he or she did not provide pleasure for the other person, that is, on the fact that the sexual activity was for the other person nonmorally bad. The moral judgment rests, more precisely, on his or her motives for not providing any pleasure, for not making the experience nonmorally good for the other person.

It is one thing to point out that as evaluative categories, moral goodness/badness is quite distinct from nonmoral goodness/badness. It is another thing to wonder, nonetheless, about the emotional or psychological connections between the moral quality of sexual activity and its nonmoral quality. Perhaps morally good sexual activity tends also to be the most satisfying sexual activity, in the nonmoral sense. Whether that is true likely depends on what we mean by “morally good” sexuality and on certain features of human moral psychology. What would our lives be like, if there were always a neat correspondence between the moral quality of a sexual act and its nonmoral quality? I am not sure what such a human sexual world would be like. But examples that violate such a neat correspondence are at the present time, in this world, easy to come by. A sexual act might be both morally and nonmorally good: consider the exciting and joyful sexual activity of a newly-married couple. But a sexual act might be morally good and nonmorally bad: consider the routine sexual acts of this couple after they have been married for ten years. A sexual act might be morally bad yet nonmorally good: one spouse in that couple, married for ten years, commits adultery with another married person and finds their sexual activity to be extraordinarily satisfying. And, finally, a sexual act might be both morally and nonmorally bad: the adulterous couple get tired of each other, eventually no longer experiencing the excitement they once knew. A world in which there was little or no discrepancy between the moral and the nonmoral quality of sexual activity might be a better world than ours, or it might be worse. I would refrain from making such a judgment unless I were pretty sure what the moral goodness and badness of sexual activity amounted to in the first place, and until I knew a lot more about human psychology. Sometimes that a sexual activity is acknowledged to be morally wrong contributes all by itself to its being nonmorally good.

6. The Dangers of Sex

Whether a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual act provides sexual pleasure is not the only factor in judging its nonmoral quality: pragmatic and prudential considerations also figure into whether a sexual act, all things considered, has a preponderance of nonmoral goodness. Many sexual activities can be physically or psychologically risky, dangerous, or harmful. Anal coitus, for example, whether carried out by a heterosexual couple or by two gay males, can damage delicate tissues and is a mechanism for the potential transmission of various HIV viruses (as is heterosexual genital intercourse). Thus in evaluating whether a sexual act will be overall nonmorally good or bad, not only its anticipated pleasure or satisfaction must be counted, but also all sorts of negative (undesired) side effects: whether the sexual act is likely to damage the body, as in some sadomasochistic acts, or transmit any one of a number of venereal diseases, or result in an unwanted pregnancy, or even whether one might feel regret, anger, or guilt afterwards as a result of having engaged in a sexual act with this person, or in this location, or under these conditions, or of a specific type. Indeed, all these pragmatic and prudential factors also figure into the moral evaluation of sexual activity: intentionally causing unwanted pain or discomfort to one’s partner, or not taking adequate precautions against the possibility of pregnancy, or not informing one’s partner of a suspected case of genital infection (but see David Mayo’s provocative dissent, in “An Obligation to Warn of HIV Infection?”), can be morally wrong. Thus, depending on what particular moral principles about sexuality one embraces, the various ingredients that constitute the nonmoral quality of sexual acts can influence one’s moral judgments.

7. Sexual Perversion

In addition to inquiring about the moral and nonmoral quality of a given sexual act or a type of sexual activity, we can also ask whether the act or type is natural or unnatural (that is, perverted). Natural sexual acts, to provide merely a broad definition, are those acts that either flow naturally from human sexual nature, or at least do not frustrate or counteract sexual tendencies that flow naturally from human sexual desire. An account of what is natural in human sexual desire and activity is part of a philosophical account of human nature in general, what we might call philosophical anthropology, which is a rather large undertaking.

Note that evaluating a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual activity as being natural or unnatural can very well be distinct from evaluating the act or type either as being morally good or bad or as being nonmorally good or bad. Suppose we assume, for the sake of discussion only, that heterosexual coitus is a natural human sexual activity and that homosexual fellatio is unnatural, or a sexual perversion. Even so, it would not follow from these judgments alone that all heterosexual coitus is morally good (some of it might be adulterous, or rape) or that all homosexual fellatio is morally wrong (some of it, engaged in by consenting adults in the privacy of their homes, might be morally permissible). Further, from the fact that heterosexual coitus is natural, it does not follow that acts of heterosexual coitus will be nonmorally good, that is, pleasurable; nor does it follow from the fact that homosexual fellatio is perverted that it does not or cannot produce sexual pleasure for those people who engage in it. Of course, both natural and unnatural sexual acts can be medically or psychologically risky or dangerous. There is no reason to assume that natural sexual acts are in general more safe than unnatural sexual acts; for example, unprotected heterosexual intercourse is likely more dangerous, in several ways, than mutual homosexual masturbation.

Since there are no necessary connections between, on the one hand, evaluating a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual activity as being natural or unnatural and, on the other hand, evaluating its moral and nonmoral quality, why would we wonder whether a sexual act or a type of sex was natural or perverted? One reason is simply that understanding what is natural and unnatural in human sexuality helps complete our picture of human nature in general, and allows us to understand our species more fully. With such deliberations, the self-reflection about humanity and the human condition that is the heart of philosophy becomes more complete. A second reason is that an account of the difference between the natural and the perverted in human sexuality might be useful for psychology, especially if we assume that a desire or tendency to engage in perverted sexual activities is a sign or symptom of an underlying mental or psychological pathology.

8. Sexual Perversion and Morality

Finally (a third reason), even though natural sexual activity is not on that score alone morally good and unnatural sexual activity is not necessarily morally wrong, it is still possible to argue that whether a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexuality is natural or unnatural does influence, to a greater or lesser extent, whether the act is morally good or morally bad. Just as whether a sexual act is nonmorally good, that is, produces pleasure for the participants, may be a factor, sometimes an important one, in our evaluating the act morally, whether a sexual act or type of sexual expression is natural or unnatural may also play a role, sometimes a large one, in deciding whether the act is morally good or bad.

A comparison between the sexual philosophy of the medieval Catholic theologian St. Thomas Aquinas and that of the contemporary secular philosophy Thomas Nagel is in this regard instructive. Both Aquinas and Nagel can be understood as assuming that what is unnatural in human sexuality is perverted, and that what is unnatural or perverted in human sexuality is simply that which does not conform with or is inconsistent with natural human sexuality. But beyond these general areas of agreement, there are deep differences between Aquinas and Nagel.

9. Aquinas’s Natural Law

Based upon a comparison of the sexuality of humans and the sexuality of lower animals (mammals, in particular), Aquinas concludes that what is natural in human sexuality is the impulse to engage in heterosexual coitus. Heterosexual coitus is the mechanism designed by the Christian God to insure the preservation of animal species, including humans, and hence engaging in this activity is the primary natural expression of human sexual nature. Further, this God designed each of the parts of the human body to carry out specific functions, and on Aquinas’s view God designed the male penis to implant sperm into the female’s vagina for the purpose of effecting procreation. It follows, for Aquinas, that depositing the sperm elsewhere than inside a human female’s vagina is unnatural: it is a violation of God’s design, contrary to the nature of things as established by God. For this reason alone, on Aquinas’s view, such activities are immoral, a grave offense to the sagacious plan of the Almighty.

Sexual intercourse with lower animals (bestiality), sexual activity with members of one’s own sex (homosexuality), and masturbation, for Aquinas, are unnatural sexual acts and are immoral exactly for that reason. If they are committed intentionally, according to one’s will, they deliberately disrupt the natural order of the world as created by God and which God commanded to be respected. (See Summa Theologiae, vol. 43, 2a2ae, qq. 153-154.) In none of these activities is there any possibility of procreation, and the sexual and other organs are used, or misused, for purposes other than that for which they were designed. Although Aquinas does not say so explicitly, but only hints in this direction, it follows from his philosophy of sexuality that fellatio, even when engaged in by heterosexuals, is also perverted and morally wrong. At least in those cases in which orgasm occurs by means of this act, the sperm is not being placed where it should be placed and procreation is therefore not possible. If the penis entering the vagina is the paradigmatic natural act, then any other combination of anatomical connections will be unnatural and hence immoral; for example, the penis, mouth, or fingers entering the anus. Note that Aquinas’s criterion of the natural, that the sexual act must be procreative in form, and hence must involve a penis inserted into a vagina, makes no mention of human psychology. Aquinas’s line of thought yields an anatomical criterion of natural and perverted sex that refers only to bodily organs and what they might accomplish physiologically and to where they are, or are not, put in relation to each other.

10. Nagel’s Secular Philosophy

Thomas Nagel denies Aquinas’s central presupposition, that in order to discover what is natural in human sexuality we should emphasize what humans and lower animals have in common. Applying this formula, Aquinas concluded that the purpose of sexual activity and the sexual organs in humans was procreation, as it is in the lower animals. Everything else in Aquinas’s sexual philosophy follows more-or-less logically from this. Nagel, by contrast, argues that to discover what is distinctive about the natural human sexuality, and hence derivatively what is unnatural or perverted, we should focus, instead, on what humans and lower animals do not have in common. We should emphasize the ways in which humans are different from animals, the ways in which humans and their sexuality are special. Thus Nagel argues that sexual perversion in humans should be understood as a psychological phenomenon rather than, as in Aquinas’s treatment, in anatomical and physiological terms. For it is human psychology that makes us quite different from other animals, and hence an account of natural human sexuality must acknowledge the uniqueness of human psychology.

Nagel proposes that sexual interactions in which each person responds with sexual arousal to noticing the sexual arousal of the other person exhibit the psychology that is natural to human sexuality. In such an encounter, each person becomes aware of himself or herself and the other person as both the subject and the object of their joint sexual experiences. Perverted sexual encounters or events would be those in which this mutual recognition of arousal is absent, and in which a person remains fully a subject of the sexual experience or fully an object. Perversion, then, is a departure from or a truncation of a psychologically “complete” pattern of arousal and consciousness. (See Nagel’s “Sexual Perversion,” pp. 15-17.) Nothing in Nagel’s psychological account of the natural and the perverted refers to bodily organs or physiological processes. That is, for a sexual encounter to be natural, it need not be procreative in form, as long as the requisite psychology of mutual recognition is present. Whether a sexual activity is natural or perverted does not depend, on Nagel’s view, on what organs are used or where they are put, but only on the character of the psychology of the sexual encounter. Thus Nagel disagrees with Aquinas that homosexual activities, as a specific type of sexual act, are unnatural or perverted, for homosexual fellatio and anal intercourse may very well be accompanied by the mutual recognition of and response to the other’s sexual arousal.

11. Fetishism

It is illuminating to compare what the views of Aquinas and Nagel imply about fetishism, that is, the usually male practice of masturbating while fondling women’s shoes or undergarments. Aquinas and Nagel agree that such activities are unnatural and perverted, but they disagree about the grounds of that evaluation. For Aquinas, masturbating while fondling shoes or undergarments is unnatural because the sperm is not deposited where it should be, and the act thereby has no procreative potential. For Nagel, masturbatory fetishism is perverted for a quite different reason: in this activity, there is no possibility of one persons’ noticing and being aroused by the arousal of another person. The arousal of the fetishist is, from the perspective of natural human psychology, defective. Note, in this example, one more difference between Aquinas and Nagel: Aquinas would judge the sexual activity of the fetishist to be immoral precisely because it is perverted (it violates a natural pattern established by God), while Nagel would not conclude that it must be morally wrong—after all, a fetishistic sexual act might be carried out quite harmlessly—even if it does indicate that something is suspicious about the fetishist’s psychology. The move historically and socially away from a Thomistic moralistic account of sexual perversion toward an amoral psychological account such as Nagel’s is representative of a more widespread trend: the gradual replacement of moral or religious judgments, about all sorts of deviant behavior, by medical or psychiatric judgments and interventions. (See Alan Soble, Sexual Investigations, chapter 4.)

12. Female Sexuality and Natural Law

A different kind of disagreement with Aquinas is registered by Christine Gudorf, a Christian theologian who otherwise has a lot in common with Aquinas. Gudorf agrees that the study of human anatomy and physiology yields insights into God’s plan and design, and that human sexual behavior should conform with God’s creative intentions. That is, Gudorf’s philosophy is squarely within the Thomistic Natural Law tradition. But Gudorf argues that if we take a careful look at the anatomy and physiology of the female sexual organs, and especially the clitoris, instead of focusing exclusively on the male’s penis (which is what Aquinas did), quite different conclusions about God’s plan and design emerge and hence Christian sexual ethics turns out to be less restrictive. In particular, Gudorf claims that the female’s clitoris is an organ whose only purpose is the production of sexual pleasure and, unlike the mixed or dual functionality of the penis, has no connection with procreation. Gudorf concludes that the existence of the clitoris in the female body suggests that God intended that the purpose of sexual activity was as much for sexual pleasure for its own sake as it was for procreation. Therefore, according to Gudorf, pleasurable sexual activity apart from procreation does not violate God’s design, is not unnatural, and hence is not necessarily morally wrong, as long as it occurs in the context of a monogamous marriage (Sex, Body, and Pleasure, p. 65). Today we are not as confident as Aquinas was that God’s plan can be discovered by a straightforward examination of human and animal bodies; but such healthy skepticism about our ability to discern the intentions of God from facts of the natural world would seem to apply to Gudorf’s proposal as well.

13. Debates in Sexual Ethics

The ethics of sexual behavior, as a branch of applied ethics, is no more and no less contentious than the ethics of anything else that is usually included within the area of applied ethics. Think, for example, of the notorious debates over euthanasia, capital punishment, abortion, and our treatment of lower animals for food, clothing, entertainment, and in medical research. So it should come as no surprise than even though a discussion of sexual ethics might well result in the removal of some confusions and a clarification of the issues, no final answers to questions about the morality of sexual activity are likely to be forthcoming from the philosophy of sexuality. As far as I can tell by surveying the literature on sexual ethics, there are at least three major topics that have received much discussion by philosophers of sexuality and which provide arenas for continual debate.

14. Natural Law vs. Liberal Ethics

We have already encountered one debate: the dispute between a Thomistic Natural Law approach to sexual morality and a more liberal, secular outlook that denies that there is a tight connection between what is unnatural in human sexuality and what is immoral. The secular liberal philosopher emphasizes the values of autonomous choice, self-determination, and pleasure in arriving at moral judgments about sexual behavior, in contrast to the Thomistic tradition that justifies a more restrictive sexual ethics by invoking a divinely imposed scheme to which human action must conform. For a secular liberal philosopher of sexuality, the paradigmatically morally wrong sexual act is rape, in which one person forces himself or herself upon another or uses threats to coerce the other to engage in sexual activity. By contrast, for the liberal, anything done voluntarily between two or more people is generally morally permissible. For the secular liberal, then, a sexual act would be morally wrong if it were dishonest, coercive, or manipulative, and Natural Law theory would agree, except to add that the act’s merely being unnatural is another, independent reason for condemning it morally. Kant, for example, held that “Onanism . . . is abuse of the sexual faculty. . . . By it man sets aside his person and degrades himself below the level of animals. . . . Intercourse between sexus homogenii . . . too is contrary to the ends of humanity”(Lectures, p. 170). The sexual liberal, however, usually finds nothing morally wrong or nonmorally bad about either masturbation or homosexual sexual activity. These activities might be unnatural, and perhaps in some ways prudentially unwise, but in many if not most cases they can be carried out without harm being done either to the participants or to anyone else.

Natural Law is alive and well today among philosophers of sex, even if the details do not match Aquinas’s original version. For example, the contemporary philosopher John Finnis argues that there are morally worthless sexual acts in which “one’s body is treated as instrumental for the securing of the experiential satisfaction of the conscious self” (see “Is Homosexual Conduct Wrong?”). For example, in masturbating or in being anally sodomized, the body is just a tool of sexual satisfaction and, as a result, the person undergoes “disintegration.” “One’s choosing self [becomes] the quasi-slave of the experiencing self which is demanding gratification.” The worthlessness and disintegration attaching to masturbation and sodomy actually attach, for Finnis, to “all extramarital sexual gratification.” This is because only in married, heterosexual coitus do the persons’ “reproductive organs . . . make them a biological . . . unit.” Finnis begins his argument with the metaphysically pessimistic intuition that sexual activity involves treating human bodies and persons instrumentally, and he concludes with the thought that sexual activity in marriage—in particular, genital intercourse—avoids disintegrity because only in this case, as intended by God’s plan, does the couple attain a state of genuine unity: “the orgasmic union of the reproductive organs of husband and wife really unites them biologically.” (See also Finnis’s essay “Law, Morality, and ‘Sexual Orientation’.”)

15. Consent Is Not Sufficient

Another debate is about whether, when there is no harm done to third parties to be concerned about, the fact that two people engage in a sexual act voluntarily, with their own free and informed consent, is sufficient for satisfying the demands of sexual morality. Of course, those in the Natural Law tradition deny that consent is sufficient, since on their view willingly engaging in unnatural sexual acts is morally wrong, but they are not alone in reducing the moral significance of consent. Sexual activity between two persons might be harmful to one or both participants, and a moral paternalist or perfectionist would claim that it is wrong for one person to harm another person, or for the latter to allow the former to engage in this harmful behavior, even when both persons provide free and informed consent to their joint activity. Consent in this case is not sufficient, and as a result some forms of sadomasochistic sexuality turn out to be morally wrong. The denial of the sufficiency of consent is also frequently presupposed by those philosophers who claim that only in a committed relationship is sexual activity between two people morally permissible. The free and informed consent of both parties may be a necessary condition for the morality of their sexual activity, but without the presence of some other ingredient (love, marriage, devotion, and the like) their sexual activity remains mere mutual use or objectification and hence morally objectionable.

In casual sex, for example, two persons are merely using each other for their own sexual pleasure; even when genuinely consensual, these mutual sexual uses do not yield a virtuous sexual act. Kant and Karol Wojtyla (Pope John Paul II) take this position: willingly allowing oneself to be used sexually by another makes an object of oneself. For Kant, sexual activity avoids treating a person merely as a means only in marriage, since here both persons have surrendered their bodies and souls to each other and have achieved a subtle metaphysical unity (Lectures, p. 167). For Wojtyla, “only love can preclude the use of one person by another” (Love and Responsibility, p. 30), since love is a unification of persons resulting from a mutual gift of their selves. Note, however, that the thought that a unifying love is the ingredient that justifies sexual activity (beyond consent) has an interesting and ironic implication: gay and lesbian sexual relations would seem to be permissible if they occur within loving, monogamous homosexual marriages (a position defended by the theologians Patricia Jung and Ralph Smith, in Heterosexism). At this point in the argument, defenders of the view that sexual activity is justifiable only in marriage commonly appeal to Natural Law to rule out homosexual marriage.

16. Consent Is Sufficient

On another view of these matters, the fact that sexual activity is carried out voluntarily by all persons involved means, assuming that no harm to third parties exists, that the sexual activity is morally permissible. In defending such a view of the sufficiency of consent, Thomas Mappes writes that “respect for persons entails that each of us recognize the rightful authority of other persons (as rational beings) to conduct their individual lives as they see fit” (“Sexual Morality and the Concept of Using Another Person,” p. 204). Allowing the other person’s consent to control when the other may engage in sexual activity with me is to respect that person by taking his or her autonomy, his or her ability to reason and make choices, seriously, while not to allow the other to make the decision about when to engage in sexual activity with me is disrespectfully paternalistic. If the other person’s consent is taken as sufficient, that shows that I respect his or her choice of ends, or that even if I do not approve of his or her particular choice of ends, at least I show respect for his or her ends-making capability. According to such a view of the power of consent, there can be no moral objection in principle to casual sexual activity, to sexual activity with strangers, or to promiscuity, as long as the persons involved in the activity genuinely agree to engage in their chosen sexual activities.

If Mappes’s free and informed consent criterion of the morality of sexual activity is correct, we would still have to address several difficult questions. How specific must consent be? When one person agrees vaguely, and in the heat of the moment, with another person, “yes, let’s have sex,” the speaker has not necessarily consented to every type of sexual caress or coital position the second person might have in mind. And how explicit must consent be? Can consent be reliably implied by involuntarily behavior (moans, for example), and do nonverbal cues (erection, lubrication) decisively show that another person has consented to sex? Some philosophers insist that consent must be exceedingly specific as to the sexual acts to be carried out, and some would permit only explicit verbal consent, denying that body language by itself can do an adequate job of expressing the participant’s desires and intentions. (See Alan Soble, “Antioch’s ‘Sexual Offense Policy’.”)

Note also that not all philosophers agree with Mappes and others that fully voluntary consent is always necessary for sexual activity to be morally permissible. Jeffrie Murphy, for example, has raised some doubts (“Some Ruminations on Women, Violence, and the Criminal Law,” p. 218):

“Have sex with me or I will find another girlfriend” strikes me (assuming normal circumstances) as a morally permissible threat, and “Have sex with me and I will marry you” strikes me (assuming the offer is genuine) as a morally permissible offer. . . . We negotiate our way through most of life with schemes of threats and offers . . . and I see no reason why the realm of sexuality should be utterly insulated from this very normal way of being human.

Murphy implies that some threats are coercive and thereby undermine the voluntary nature of the participation in sexual activity of one of the persons, but, he adds, these types of threats are not always morally wrong. Alternatively, we might say that in the cases Murphy describes, the threats and offers do not constitute coercion at all and that they present no obstacle to fully voluntary participation. (See Alan Wertheimer, “Consent and Sexual Relations.”) If so, Murphy’s cases do not establish that voluntary consent is not always required for sexual activity to be morally right.

17. What Is “Voluntary”?

As suggested by Murphy’s examples, another debate concerns the meaning and application of the concept “voluntary.” Whether consent is only necessary for the morality of sexual activity, or also sufficient, any moral principle that relies on consent to make moral distinctions among sexual events presupposes a clear understanding of the “voluntary” aspect of consent. It is safe to say that participation in sexual activity ought not to be physically forced upon one person by another. But this obvious truth leaves matters wide open. Onora O’Neill, for example, thinks that casual sex is morally wrong because the consent it purportedly involves is not likely to be sufficiently voluntary, in light of subtle pressures people commonly put on each other to engage in sexual activity (see “Between Consenting Adults”).

One moral ideal is that genuinely consensual participation in sexual activity requires not a hint of coercion or pressure of any sort. Because engaging in sexual activity can be risky or dangerous in many ways, physically, psychologically, and metaphysically, we would like to be sure, according to this moral ideal, that anyone who engages in sexual activity does so perfectly voluntarily. Some philosophers have argued that this ideal can be realized only when there is substantial economic and social equality between the persons involved in a given sexual encounter. For example, a society that exhibits disparities in the incomes or wealth of its various members is one in which some people will be exposed to economic coercion. If some groups of people (women and members of ethnic minorities, in particular) have less economic and social power than others, members of these groups will be therefore exposed to sexual coercion in particular, among other kinds. One immediate application of this thought is that prostitution, which to many sexual liberals is a business bargain made by a provider of sexual services and a client and is largely characterized by adequately free and informed consent, may be morally wrong, if the economic situation of the prostitute acts as a kind of pressure that negates the voluntary nature of his or her participation. Further, women with children who are economically dependent on their husbands may find themselves in the position of having to engage in sexual activity whether they want to or not, for fear of being abandoned; these women, too, may not be engaging in sexual activity fully voluntarily. The woman who allows herself to be nagged into sex by her husband worries that if she says “no” too often, she will suffer economically, if not also physically and psychologically.

The view that the presence of any kind of pressure at all is coercive, negates the voluntary nature of participation in sexual activity, and hence is morally objectionable has been expressed by Charlene Muehlenhard and Jennifer Schrag (see their “Nonviolent Sexual Coercion”). They list, among other things, “status coercion” (when women are coerced into sexual activity or marriage by a man’s occupation) and “discrimination against lesbians” (which discrimination compels women into having sexual relationships only with men) as forms of coercion that undermine the voluntary nature of participation by women in sexual activity with men. But depending on the kind of case we have in mind, it might be more accurate to say either that some pressures are not coercive and do not appreciably undermine voluntariness, or that some pressures are coercive but are nevertheless not morally objectionable. Is it always true that the presence of any kind of pressure put on one person by another amounts to coercion that negates the voluntary nature of consent, so that subsequent sexual activity is morally wrong?

18. Conceptual Analysis

Conceptual philosophy of sexuality is concerned to analyze and to clarify concepts that are central in this area of philosophy: sexual activity, sexual desire, sexual sensation, sexual perversion, and others. It also attempts to define less abstract concepts, such as prostitution, pornography, and rape. I would like to illustrate the conceptual philosophy of sexuality by focusing on one particular concept, that of “sexual activity,” and explore in what ways it is related to another central concept, that of “sexual pleasure.” One lesson to be learned here is that conceptual philosophy of sexuality can be just as difficult and contentious as normative philosophy of sexuality, and that as a result firm conceptual conclusions are hard to come by.

19. Sexual Activity vs. “Having Sex”

According to a notorious study published in 1999 in the Journal of the American Medical Association (“Would You Say You ‘Had Sex’ If . . . ?” by Stephanie Sanders and June Reinisch), a large percent of undergraduate college students, about 60%, do not think that engaging in oral sex (fellatio and cunnilingus) is “having sex.” This finding is at first glance very surprising, but it is not difficult to comprehend sympathetically. To be sure, as philosophers we easily conclude that oral sex is a specific type of sexual activity. But “sexual activity” is a technical concept, while “having sex” is an ordinary language concept, which refers primarily to heterosexual intercourse. Thus when Monica Lewinsky told her confidant Linda Tripp that she did not “have sex” with William Jefferson Clinton, she was not necessarily self-deceived, lying, or pulling a fast one. She was merely relying on the ordinary language definition or criterion of “having sex,” which is not identical to the philosopher’s concept of “sexual activity,” does not always include oral sex, and usually requires genital intercourse.

Another conclusion might be drawn from the JAMA survey. If we assume that heterosexual coitus by and large, or in many cases, produces more pleasure for the participants than does oral sex, or at least that in heterosexual intercourse there is greater mutuality of sexual pleasure than in one-directional oral sex, and this is why ordinary thought tends to discount the ontological significance of oral sex, then perhaps we can use this to fashion a philosophical account of “sexual activity” that is at once consistent with ordinary thought.

20. Sexual Activity and Sexual Pleasure

In common thought, whether a sexual act is nonmorally good or bad is often associated with whether it is judged to be a sexual act at all. Sometimes we derive little or no pleasure from a sexual act (say, we are primarily giving pleasure to another person, or we are even selling it to the other person), and we think that even though the other person had a sexual experience, we didn’t. Or the other person did try to provide us with sexual pleasure but failed miserably, whether from ignorance of technique or sheer sexual crudity. In such a case it would not be implausible to say that we did not undergo a sexual experience and so did not engage in a sexual act. If Ms. Lewinsky’s performing oral sex on President Clinton was done only for his sake, for his sexual pleasure, and she did it out of consideration for his needs and not hers, then perhaps she did not herself, after all, engage in a sexual act.

Robert Gray is one philosopher who has taken up this line of ordinary thought and has argued that “sexual activity” should be analyzed in terms of the production of sexual pleasure. He asserts that “any activity might become a sexual activity” if sexual pleasure is derived from it, and “no activity is a sexual activity unless sexual pleasure is derived from it” (“Sex and Sexual Perversion,” p. 61). Perhaps Gray is right, since we tend to think that holding hands is a sexual activity when sexual pleasure is produced by doing so, but otherwise holding hands is not very sexual. A handshake is normally not a sexual act, and usually does not yield sexual pleasure; but two lovers caressing each other’s fingers is both a sexual act and produces sexual pleasure for them.

There is another reason for taking seriously the idea that sexual activities are exactly those that produce sexual pleasure. What is it about a sexually perverted activity that makes it sexual? The act is unnatural, we might say, because it has no connection with one common purpose of sexual activity, that is, procreation. But the only thing that would seem to make the act a sexual perversion is that it does, on a fairly reliable basis, nonetheless produce sexual pleasure. Undergarment fetishism is a sexual perversion, and not merely, say, a “fabric” perversion, because it involves sexual pleasure. Similarly, what is it about homosexual sexual activities that makes them sexual? All such acts are nonprocreative, yet they share something very important in common with procreative heterosexual activities: they produce sexual pleasure, and the same sort of sexual pleasure.

a. Sexual Activity Without Pleasure

Suppose I were to ask you, “How many sexual partners have you had during the last five years”? If you were on your toes, you would ask me, before answering, “What counts as a sexual partner?” (Maybe you are suspicious of my question because you had read Greta Christina’s essay on this topic, “Are We Having Sex Now or What?”) At this point I should give you an adequate analysis of “sexual activity,” and tell you to count anyone with whom you engaged in sexual activity according to this definition. What I should definitely not do is to tell you to count only those people with whom you had a pleasing or satisfactory sexual experience, forgetting about, and hence not counting, those partners with whom you had nonmorally bad sex. But if we accept Gray’s analysis of sexual activity, that sexual acts are exactly those and only those that produce sexual pleasure, I should of course urge you not to count, over those five years, anyone with whom you had a nonmorally bad sexual experience. You will end up reporting to me fewer sexual partners than you in fact had. Maybe that will make you feel better.

The general point is this. If “sexual activity” is logically dependent on “sexual pleasure,” if sexual pleasure is thereby the criterion of sexual activity itself, then sexual pleasure cannot be the gauge of the nonmoral quality of sexual activities. That is, this analysis of “sexual activity” in terms of “sexual pleasure” conflates what it is for an act to be a sexual activity with what it is for an act to be a nonmorally good sexual activity. On such an analysis, procreative sexual activities, when the penis is placed into the vagina, would be sexual activities only when they produce sexual pleasure, and not when they are as sensually boring as a handshake. Further, the victim of a rape, who has not experienced nonmorally good sex, cannot claim that he or she was forced to engage in sexual activity, even if the act compelled on him or her was intercourse or fellatio.

I would prefer to say that the couple who have lost sexual interest in each other, and who engage in routine sexual activities from which they derive no pleasure, are still performing a sexual act. But we are forbidden, by Gray’s proposed analysis, from saying that they engage in nonmorally bad sexual activity, for on his view they have not engaged in any sexual activity at all. Rather, we could say at most that they tried to engage in sexual activity but failed to do so. It may be a sad fact about our sexual world that we can engage in sexual activity and not derive any or much pleasure from it, but that fact should not give us reason for refusing to call these unsatisfactory events “sexual.”

21. References and Further Reading

Aquinas, St. Thomas. Summa Theologiae. Cambridge, Eng.: Blackfriars, 1964-76.
Augustine, St. (Aurelius). On Marriage and Concupiscence, in The Works of Aurelius Augustine, Bishop of Hippo, vol. 12, ed. Marcus Dods. Edinburgh, Scot.: T. & T. Clark, 1874.
Baker, Robert, Kathleen Wininger, and Frederick Elliston, eds. Philosophy and Sex, 3rd edition. Amherst, N.Y.: Prometheus, 1998.
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Author Information

Alan Soble
Email: ags38@drexel.edu
Drexel University
U. S. A.

Plato (427—347 B.C.E.)

plato Plato is one of the world’s best known and most widely read and studied philosophers. He was the student of Socrates and the teacher of Aristotle, and he wrote in the middle of the fourth century B.C.E. in ancient Greece. Though influenced primarily by Socrates, to the extent that Socrates is usually the main character in many of Plato’s writings, he was also influenced by Heraclitus, Parmenides, and the Pythagoreans.

There are varying degrees of controversy over which of Plato’s works are authentic, and in what order they were written, due to their antiquity and the manner of their preservation through time. Nonetheless, his earliest works are generally regarded as the most reliable of the ancient sources on Socrates, and the character Socrates that we know through these writings is considered to be one of the greatest of the ancient philosophers.

Plato’s middle to later works, including his most famous work, the Republic, are generally regarded as providing Plato’s own philosophy, where the main character in effect speaks for Plato himself. These works blend ethics, political philosophy, moral psychology, epistemology, and metaphysics into an interconnected and systematic philosophy. It is most of all from Plato that we get the theory of Forms, according to which the world we know through the senses is only an imitation of the pure, eternal, and unchanging world of the Forms. Plato’s works also contain the origins of the familiar complaint that the arts work by inflaming the passions, and are mere illusions. We also are introduced to the ideal of “Platonic love:” Plato saw love as motivated by a longing for the highest Form of beauty—The Beautiful Itself, and love as the motivational power through which the highest of achievements are possible. Because they tended to distract us into accepting less than our highest potentials, however, Plato mistrusted and generally advised against physical expressions of love.

Biography
Influences on Plato
Plato’s Writings
Other Works Attributed to Plato
The Early Dialogues
The Middle Dialogues
Late Transitional and Late Dialogues
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

a. Birth

It is widely accepted that Plato, the Athenian philosopher, was born in 428-7 B.C.E and died at the age of eighty or eighty-one at 348-7 B.C.E. These dates, however, are not entirely certain, for according to Diogenes Laertius (D.L.), following Apollodorus’ chronology, Plato was born the year Pericles died, was six years younger than Isocrates, and died at the age of eighty-four (D.L. 3.2-3.3). If Plato’s date of death is correct in Apollodorus’ version, Plato would have been born in 430 or 431. Diogenes’ claim that Plato was born the year Pericles died would put his birth in 429. Later (at 3.6), Diogenes says that Plato was twenty-eight when Socrates was put to death (in 399), which would, again, put his year of birth at 427. In spite of the confusion, the dates of Plato’s life we gave above, which are based upon Eratosthenes’ calculations, have traditionally been accepted as accurate.

b. Family

Little can be known about Plato’s early life. According to Diogenes, whose testimony is notoriously unreliable, Plato’s parents were Ariston and Perictione (or Potone—see D. L. 3.1). Both sides of the family claimed to trace their ancestry back to Poseidon (D.L. 3.1). Diogenes’ report that Plato’s birth was the result of Ariston’s rape of Perictione (D.L. 3.1) is a good example of the unconfirmed gossip in which Diogenes so often indulges. We can be confident that Plato also had two older brothers, Glaucon and Adeimantus, and a sister, Potone, by the same parents (see D.L. 3.4). (W. K. C. Guthrie, A History of Greek Philosophy, vol. 4, 10 n. 4 argues plausibly that Glaucon and Adeimantus were Plato’s older siblings.) After Ariston’s death, Plato’s mother married her uncle, Pyrilampes (in Plato’s Charmides, we are told that Pyrilampes was Charmides’ uncle, and Charmides was Plato’s mother’s brother), with whom she had another son, Antiphon, Plato’s half-brother (see Plato, Parmenides 126a-b).

Plato came from one of the wealthiest and most politically active families in Athens. Their political activities, however, are not seen as laudable ones by historians. One of Plato’s uncles (Charmides) was a member of the notorious “Thirty Tyrants,” who overthrew the Athenian democracy in 404 B.C.E. Charmides’ own uncle, Critias, was the leader of the Thirty. Plato’s relatives were not exclusively associated with the oligarchic faction in Athens, however. His stepfather Pyrilampes was said to have been a close associate of Pericles, when he was the leader of the democratic faction.

Plato’s actual given name was apparently Aristocles, after his grandfather. “Plato” seems to have started as a nickname (for platos, or “broad”), perhaps first given to him by his wrestling teacher for his physique, or for the breadth of his style, or even the breadth of his forehead (all given in D.L. 3.4). Although the name Aristocles was still given as Plato’s name on one of the two epitaphs on his tomb (see D.L. 3.43), history knows him as Plato.

c. Early Travels and the Founding of the Academy

When Socrates died, Plato left Athens, staying first in Megara, but then going on to several other places, including perhaps Cyrene, Italy, Sicily, and even Egypt. Strabo (17.29) claims that he was shown where Plato lived when he visited Heliopolis in Egypt. Plato occasionally mentions Egypt in his works, but not in ways that reveal much of any consequence (see, for examples, Phaedrus 274c-275b; Philebus 19b).

Better evidence may be found for his visits to Italy and Sicily, especially in the Seventh Letter. According to the account given there, Plato first went to Italy and Sicily when he was “about forty” (324a). While he stayed in Syracuse, he became the instructor to Dion, brother-in-law of the tyrant Dionysius I. According to doubtful stories from later antiquity, Dionysius became annoyed with Plato at some point during this visit, and arranged to have the philosopher sold into slavery (Diod. 15.7; Plut. Dion 5; D.L. 3.19-21).

In any event, Plato returned to Athens and founded a school, known as the Academy. (This is where we get our word, “academic.” The Academy got its name from its location, a grove of trees sacred to the hero Academus—or Hecademus [see D.L. 3.7]—a mile or so outside the Athenian walls; the site can still be visited in modern Athens, but visitors will find it depressingly void of interesting monuments or features.) Except for two more trips to Sicily, the Academy seems to have been Plato’s home base for the remainder of his life.

d. Later Trips to Sicily and Death

The first of Plato’s remaining two Sicilian adventures came after Dionysius I died and his young son, Dionysius II, ascended to the throne. His uncle/brother-in-law Dion persuaded the young tyrant to invite Plato to come to help him become a philosopher-ruler of the sort described in the Republic. Although the philosopher (now in his sixties) was not entirely persuaded of this possibility (Seventh Letter 328b-c), he agreed to go. This trip, like the last one, however, did not go well at all. Within months, the younger Dionysius had Dion sent into exile for sedition (Seventh Letter 329c, Third Letter 316c-d), and Plato became effectively under house arrest as the “personal guest” of the dictator (Seventh Letter 329c-330b).

Plato eventually managed to gain the tyrant’s permission to return to Athens (Seventh Letter 338a), and he and Dion were reunited at the Academy (Plut. Dion 17). Dionysius agreed that “after the war” (Seventh Letter 338a; perhaps the Lucanian War in 365 B.C.E.), he would invite Plato and Dion back to Syracuse (Third Letter 316e-317a, Seventh Letter 338a-b). Dion and Plato stayed in Athens for the next four years (c. 365-361 B.C.E.). Dionysius then summoned Plato, but wished for Dion to wait a while longer. Dion accepted the condition and encouraged Plato to go immediately anyway (Third Letter 317a-b, Seventh Letter 338b-c), but Plato refused the invitation, much to the consternation of both Syracusans (Third Letter 317a, Seventh Letter 338c). Hardly a year had passed, however, before Dionysius sent a ship, with one of Plato’s Pythagorean friends (Archedemus, an associate of Archytas—see Seventh Letter 339a-b and next section) on board begging Plato to return to Syracuse. Partly because of his friend Dion’s enthusiasm for the plan, Plato departed one more time to Syracuse. Once again, however, things in Syracuse were not at all to Plato’s liking. Dionysius once again effectively imprisoned Plato in Syracuse, and the latter was only able to escape again with help from his Tarentine friends ( Seventh Letter 350a-b).

Dion subsequently gathered an army of mercenaries and invaded his own homeland. But his success was short-lived: he was assassinated and Sicily was reduced to chaos. Plato, perhaps now completely disgusted with politics, returned to his beloved Academy, where he lived out the last thirteen years of his life. According to Diogenes, Plato was buried at the school he founded (D.L. 3.41). His grave, however, has not yet been discovered by archeological investigations.

2. Influences on Plato

a. Heraclitus

Aristotle and Diogenes agree that Plato had some early association with either the philosophy of Heraclitus of Ephesus, or with one or more of that philosopher’s followers (see Aristotle Metaph. 987a32, D.L. 3.4-3.5). The effects of this influence can perhaps be seen in the mature Plato’s conception of the sensible world as ceaselessly changing.

b. Parmenides and Zeno

There can be no doubt that Plato was also strongly influenced by Parmenides and Zeno (both of Elea), in Plato’s theory of the Forms, which are plainly intended to satisfy the Parmenidean requirement of metaphysical unity and stability in knowable reality. Parmenides and Zeno also appear as characters in his dialogue, the Parmenides. Diogenes Laertius also notes other important influences:

He mixed together in his works the arguments of Heracleitus, the Pythagoreans, and Socrates. Regarding the sensibles, he borrows from Heraclitus; regarding the intelligibles, from Pythagoras; and regarding politics, from Socrates. (D.L. 3.8)

A little later, Diogenes makes a series of comparisons intended to show how much Plato owed to the comic poet, Epicharmus (3.9-3.17).

c. The Pythagoreans

Diogenes Laertius (3.6) claims that Plato visited several Pythagoreans in Southern Italy (one of whom, Theodorus, is also mentioned as a friend to Socrates in Plato’s Theaetetus). In the Seventh Letter, we learn that Plato was a friend of Archytas of Tarentum, a well-known Pythagorean statesman and thinker (see 339d-e), and in the Phaedo, Plato has Echecrates, another Pythagorean, in the group around Socrates on his final day in prison. Plato’s Pythagorean influences seem especially evident in his fascination with mathematics, and in some of his political ideals (see Plato’s political philosophy), expressed in various ways in several dialogues.

d. Socrates

Nonetheless, it is plain that no influence on Plato was greater than that of Socrates. This is evident not only in many of the doctrines and arguments we find in Plato’s dialogues, but perhaps most obviously in Plato’s choice of Socrates as the main character in most of his works. According to the Seventh Letter, Plato counted Socrates “the justest man alive” (324e). According to Diogenes Laertius, the respect was mutual (3.5).

3. Plato’s Writings

a. Plato’s Dialogues and the Historical Socrates

Supposedly possessed of outstanding intellectual and artistic ability even from his youth, according to Diogenes, Plato began his career as a writer of tragedies, but hearing Socrates talk, he wholly abandoned that path, and even burned a tragedy he had hoped to enter in a dramatic competition (D.L. 3.5). Whether or not any of these stories is true, there can be no question of Plato’s mastery of dialogue, characterization, and dramatic context. He may, indeed, have written some epigrams; of the surviving epigrams attributed to him in antiquity, some may be genuine.

Plato was not the only writer of dialogues in which Socrates appears as a principal character and speaker. Others, including Alexamenos of Teos (Aristotle Poetics 1447b11; De Poetis fr. 3 Ross [=Rose² 72]), Aeschines (D.L. 2.60-63, 3.36, Plato Apology 33e), Antisthenes (D.L. 3.35, 6; Plato, Phaedo 59b; Xenophon, Memorabilia 2.4.5, 3.2.17), Aristippus (D.L. 2.65-104, 3.36, Plato Phaedo 59c), Eucleides (D.L. 2.106-112), Phaedo (D.L. 2.105; Plato, Phaedo passim), Simon (D.L. 122-124), and especially Xenophon (see D.L. 2.48-59, 3.34), were also well-known “Socratics” who composed such works. A recent study of these, by Charles H. Kahn (1996, 1-35), concludes that the very existence of the genre—and all of the conflicting images of Socrates we find given by the various authors—shows that we cannot trust as historically reliable any of the accounts of Socrates given in antiquity, including those given by Plato.

But it is one thing to claim that Plato was not the only one to write Socratic dialogues, and quite another to hold that Plato was only following the rules of some genre of writings in his own work. Such a claim, at any rate, is hardly established simply by the existence of these other writers and their writings. We may still wish to ask whether Plato’s own use of Socrates as his main character has anything at all to do with the historical Socrates. The question has led to a number of seemingly irresolvable scholarly disputes. At least one important ancient source, Aristotle, suggests that at least some of the doctrines Plato puts into the mouth of the “Socrates” of the “early” or “Socrates” dialogues are the very ones espoused by the historical Socrates. Because Aristotle has no reason not to be truthful about this issue, many scholars believe that his testimony provides a solid basis for distinguishing the “Socrates” of the “early” dialogues from the character by that name in Plato’s supposedly later works, whose views and arguments Aristotle suggests are Plato’s own.

b. Dating Plato’s Dialogues

One way to approach this issue has been to find some way to arrange the dialogues into at least relative dates. It has frequently been assumed that if we can establish a relative chronology for when Plato wrote each of the dialogues, we can provide some objective test for the claim that Plato represented Socrates more accurately in the earlier dialogues, and less accurately in the later dialogues.

In antiquity, the ordering of Plato’s dialogues was given entirely along thematic lines. The best reports of these orderings (see Diogenes Laertius’ discussion at 3.56-62) included many works whose authenticity is now either disputed or unanimously rejected. The uncontroversial internal and external historical evidence for a chronological ordering is relatively slight. Aristotle (Politics 2.6.1264b24-27), Diogenes Laertius (3.37), and Olympiodorus (Prol. 6.24) state that Plato wrote the Laws after the Republic. Internal references in the Sophist (217a) and the Statesman (also known as the Politicus; 257a, 258b) show the Statesman to come after the Sophist. The Timaeus (17b-19b) may refer to Republic as coming before it, and more clearly mentions the Critias as following it (27a). Similarly, internal references in the Sophist (216a, 217c) and the Theaetetus (183e) may be thought to show the intended order of three dialogues: Parmenides, Theaetetus, and Sophist. Even so, it does not follow that these dialogues were actually written in that order. At Theaetetus 143c, Plato announces through his characters that he will abandon the somewhat cumbersome dialogue form that is employed in his other writings. Since the form does not appear in a number of other writings, it is reasonable to infer that those in which it does not appear were written after the Theaetetus.

Scholars have sought to augment this fairly scant evidence by employing different methods of ordering the remaining dialogues. One such method is that of stylometry, by which various aspects of Plato’s diction in each dialogue are measured against their uses and frequencies in other dialogues. Originally done by laborious study by individuals, stylometry can now be done more efficiently with assistance by computers. Another, even more popular, way to sort and group the dialogues is what is called “content analysis,” which works by finding and enumerating apparent commonalities or differences in the philosophical style and content of the various dialogues. Neither of these general approaches has commanded unanimous assent among scholars, and it is unlikely that debates about this topic can ever be put entirely to rest. Nonetheless, most recent scholarship seems to assume that Plato’s dialogues can be sorted into different groups, and it is not unusual for books and articles on the philosophy of Socrates to state that by “Socrates” they mean to refer to the character in Plato’s “early” or Socratic dialogues, as if this Socrates was as close to the historical Socrates as we are likely to get. (We have more to say on this subject in the next section.) Perhaps the most thorough examination of this sort can be found in Gregory Vlastos’s, Socrates: Ironist and Moral Philosopher (Cambridge and Cornell, 1991, chapters 2-4), where ten significant differences between the “Socrates” of Plato’s “early” dialogues and the character by that name in the later dialogues are noted. Our own view of the probable dates and groups of dialogues, which to some extent combine the results of stylometry and content analysis, is as follows (all lists but the last in alphabetical order):

Early
(All after the death of Socrates, but before Plato’s first trip to Sicily in 387 B.C.E.):

Apology, Charmides, Crito, Euthydemus, Euthyphro, Gorgias, Hippias Major, Hippias Minor, Ion, Laches, Lysis, Protagoras, Republic Bk. I.

Early-Transitional
(Either at the end of the early group or at the beginning of the middle group, c. 387-380 B.C.E.):

Cratylus, Menexenus, Meno

Middle
(c. 380-360 B.C.E.)

Phaedo, Republic Bks. II-X, Symposium

Late-Transitional
(Either at the end of the middle group, or the beginning of the late group, c. 360-355 B.C.E.)

Parmenides, Theaetetus, Phaedrus

Late
(c. 355-347 B.C.E.; possibly in chronological order)

Sophist, Statesman, Philebus, Timaeus, Critias, Laws

c. Transmission of Plato’s Works

Except for the Timaeus, all of Plato’s works were lost to the Western world until medieval times, preserved only by Moslem scholars in the Middle East. In 1578 Henri Estienne (whose Latinized name was Stephanus) published an edition of the dialogues in which each page of the text is separated into five sections (labeled a, b, c, d, and e). The standard style of citation for Platonic texts includes the name of the text, followed by Stephanus page and section numbers (e.g. Republic 511d). Scholars sometimes also add numbers after the Stephanus section letters, which refer to line numbers within the Stephanus sections in the standard Greek edition of the dialogues, the Oxford Classical texts.

4. Other Works Attributed to Plato

a. Spuria

Several other works, including thirteen letters and eighteen epigrams, have been attributed to Plato. These other works are generally called the spuria and the dubia. The spuria were collected among the works of Plato but suspected as frauds even in antiquity. The dubia are those presumed authentic in later antiquity, but which have more recently been doubted.

Ten of the spuria are mentioned by Diogenes Laertius at 3.62. Five of these are no longer extant: the Midon or Horse-breeder, Phaeacians, Chelidon, Seventh Day, and Epimenides. Five others do exist: the Halcyon, Axiochus, Demodocus, Eryxias, and Sisyphus. To the ten Diogenes Laertius lists, we may uncontroversially add On Justice, On Virtue, and the Definitions, which was included in the medieval manuscripts of Plato’s work, but not mentioned in antiquity.

Works whose authenticity was also doubted in antiquity include the Second Alcibiades (or Alcibiades II), Epinomis, Hipparchus, and Rival Lovers (also known as either Rivals or Lovers), and these are sometimes defended as authentic today. If any are of these are authentic, the Epinomis would be in the late group, and the others would go with the early or early transitional groups.

b. Epigrams

Seventeen or eighteen epigrams (poems appropriate to funerary monuments or other dedications) are also attributed to Plato by various ancient authors. Most of these are almost certainly not by Plato, but some few may be authentic. Of the ones that could be authentic (Cooper 1997, 1742 names 1, 2, 7, and especially 3 as possibly authentic), one (1) is a love poem dedicated to a student of astronomy, perhaps at the Academy, another (2) appears to be a funerary inscription for that same student, another (3) is a funerary inscription for Plato’s Syracusan friend, Dion (in which the author confesses that Dion “maddened my heart with erôs“), and the last (7) is a love poem to a young woman or girl. None appear to provide anything of great philosophical interest.

c. Dubia

The dubia present special risks to scholars: On the one hand, any decision not to include them among the authentic dialogues creates the risk of losing valuable evidence for Plato’s (or perhaps Socrates’) philosophy; on the other hand, any decision to include them creates the risk of obfuscating the correct view of Plato’s (or Socrates’) philosophy, by including non-Platonic (or non-Socratic) elements within that philosophy. The dubia include the First Alcibiades (or Alcibiades I), Minos, and Theages, all of which, if authentic, would probably go with the early or early transitional groups, the Cleitophon, which might be early, early transitional, or middle, and the letters, of which the Seventh seems the best candidate for authenticity. Some scholars have also suggested the possibility that the Third may also be genuine. If any are authentic, the letters would appear to be works of the late period, with the possible exception of the Thirteenth Letter, which could be from the middle period.

Nearly all of the dialogues now accepted as genuine have been challenged as inauthentic by some scholar or another. In the 19th Century in particular, scholars often considered arguments for and against the authenticity of dialogues whose authenticity is now only rarely doubted. Of those we listed as authentic, above (in the early group), only the Hippias Major continues occasionally to be listed as inauthentic. The strongest evidence against the authenticity of the Hippias Major is the fact that it is never mentioned in any of the ancient sources. However, relative to how much was actually written in antiquity, so little now remains that our lack of ancient references to this dialogue does not seem to be an adequate reason to doubt its authenticity. In style and content, it seems to most contemporary scholars to fit well with the other Platonic dialogues.

5. The Early Dialogues

a. Historical Accuracy

Although no one thinks that Plato simply recorded the actual words or speeches of Socrates verbatim, the argument has been made that there is nothing in the speeches Socrates makes in the Apology that he could have not uttered at the historical trial. At any rate, it is fairly common for scholars to treat Plato’s Apology as the most reliable of the ancient sources on the historical Socrates. The other early dialogues are certainly Plato’s own creations. But as we have said, most scholars treat these as representing more or less accurately the philosophy and behavior of the historical Socrates—even if they do not provide literal historical records of actual Socratic conversations. Some of the early dialogues include anachronisms that prove their historical inaccuracy.

It is possible, of course, that the dialogues are all wholly Plato’s inventions and have nothing at all to do with the historical Socrates. Contemporary scholars generally endorse one of the following four views about the dialogues and their representation of Socrates:

The Unitarian View:
This view, more popular early in the 20th Century than it is now, holds that there is but a single philosophy to be found in all of Plato’s works (of any period, if such periods can even be identified reliably). There is no reason, according to the Unitarian scholar, ever to talk about “Socratic philosophy” (at least from anything to be found in Plato—everything in Plato’s dialogues is Platonic philosophy, according to the Unitarian). One recent version of this view has been argued by Charles H. Kahn (1996). Most later, but still ancient, interpretations of Plato were essentially Unitarian in their approach. Aristotle, however, was a notable exception.
The Literary Atomist View:
We call this approach the “literary atomist view,” because those who propose this view treat each dialogue as a complete literary whole, whose proper interpretation must be achieved without reference to any of Plato’s other works. Those who endorse this view reject completely any relevance or validity of sorting or grouping the dialogues into groups, on the ground that any such sorting is of no value to the proper interpretation of any given dialogue. In this view, too, there is no reason to make any distinction between “Socratic philosophy” and “Platonic philosophy.” According to the literary atomist, all philosophy to be found in the works of Plato should be attributed only to Plato.
The Developmentalist View:
According to this view, the most widely held of all of the interpretative approaches, the differences between the early and later dialogues represent developments in Plato’s own philosophical and literary career. These may or may not be related to his attempting in any of the dialogues to preserve the memory of the historical Socrates (see approach 4); such differences may only represent changes in Plato’s own philosophical views. Developmentalists may generally identify the earlier positions or works as “Socratic” and the later ones “Platonic,” but may be agnostic about the relationship of the “Socratic” views and works to the actual historical Socrates.
The Historicist View:
Perhaps the most common of the Developmentalist positions is the view that the “development” noticeable between the early and later dialogues may be attributed to Plato’s attempt, in the early dialogues, to represent the historical Socrates more or less accurately. Later on, however (perhaps because of the development of the genre of “Socratic writings,” within which other authors were making no attempt at historical fidelity), Plato began more freely to put his own views into the mouth of the character, “Socrates,” in his works. Plato’s own student, Aristotle, seems to have understood the dialogues in this way.

Now, some scholars who are skeptical about the entire program of dating the dialogues into chronological groups, and who are thus strictly speaking not historicists (see, for example, Cooper 1997, xii-xvii) nonetheless accept the view that the “early” works are “Socratic” in tone and content. With few exceptions, however, scholars agreed that if we are unable to distinguish any group of dialogues as early or “Socratic,” or even if we can distinguish a separate set of “Socratic” works but cannot identify a coherent philosophy within those works, it makes little sense to talk about “the philosophy of historical Socrates” at all. There is just too little (and too little that is at all interesting) to be found that could reliably be attributed to Socrates from any other ancient authors. Any serious philosophical interest in Socrates, then, must be pursued through study of Plato’s early or “Socratic” dialogues.

b. Plato’s Characterization of Socrates

In the dialogues generally accepted as early (or “Socratic”), the main character is always Socrates. Socrates is represented as extremely agile in question-and-answer, which has come to be known as “the Socratic method of teaching,” or “the elenchus” (or elenchos, from the Greek term for refutation), with Socrates nearly always playing the role as questioner, for he claimed to have no wisdom of his own to share with others. Plato’s Socrates, in this period, was adept at reducing even the most difficult and recalcitrant interlocutors to confusion and self-contradiction. In the Apology, Socrates explains that the embarrassment he has thus caused to so many of his contemporaries is the result of a Delphic oracle given to Socrates’ friend Chaerephon (Apology 21a-23b), according to which no one was wiser than Socrates. As a result of his attempt to discern the true meaning of this oracle, Socrates gained a divinely ordained mission in Athens to expose the false conceit of wisdom. The embarrassment his “investigations” have caused to so many of his contemporaries—which Socrates claims was the root cause of his being brought up on charges (Apology 23c-24b)—is thus no one’s fault but his “victims,” for having chosen to live “the unexamined life” (see 38a).

The way that Plato’s represents Socrates going about his “mission” in Athens provides a plausible explanation both of why the Athenians would have brought him to trial and convicted him in the troubled years after the end of the Peloponnesian War, and also of why Socrates was not really guilty of the charges he faced. Even more importantly, however, Plato’s early dialogues provide intriguing arguments and refutations of proposed philosophical positions that interest and challenge philosophical readers. Platonic dialogues continue to be included among the required readings in introductory and advanced philosophy classes, not only for their ready accessibility, but also because they raise many of the most basic problems of philosophy. Unlike most other philosophical works, moreover, Plato frames the discussions he represents in dramatic settings that make the content of these discussions especially compelling. So, for example, in the Crito, we find Socrates discussing the citizen’s duty to obey the laws of the state as he awaits his own legally mandated execution in jail, condemned by what he and Crito both agree was a terribly wrong verdict, the result of the most egregious misapplication of the very laws they are discussing. The dramatic features of Plato’s works have earned attention even from literary scholars relatively uninterested in philosophy as such. Whatever their value for specifically historical research, therefore, Plato’s dialogues will continue to be read and debated by students and scholars, and the Socrates we find in the early or “Socratic” dialogues will continue to be counted among the greatest Western philosophers.

c. Ethical Positions in the Early Dialogues

The philosophical positions most scholars agree can be found directly endorsed or at least suggested in the early or “Socratic” dialogues include the following moral or ethical views:

A rejection of retaliation, or the return of harm for harm or evil for evil (Crito 48b-c, 49c-d; Republic I.335a-e);
The claim that doing injustice harms one’s soul, the thing that is most precious to one, and, hence, that it is better to suffer injustice than to do it (Crito 47d-48a; Gorgias 478c-e, 511c-512b; Republic I.353d-354a);
Some form of what is called “eudaimonism,” that is, that goodness is to be understood in terms of conduciveness to human happiness, well-being, or flourishing, which may also be understood as “living well,” or “doing well” (Crito 48b; Euthydemus 278e, 282a; Republic I. 354a);
The view that only virtue is good just by itself; anything else that is good is good only insofar as it serves or is used for or by virtue (Apology 30b; Euthydemus 281d-e);
The view that there is some kind of unity among the virtues: In some sense, all of the virtues are the same (Protagoras 329b-333b, 361a-b);
The view that the citizen who has agreed to live in a state must always obey the laws of that state, or else persuade the state to change its laws, or leave the state (Crito 51b-c, 52a-d).

d. Psychological Positions in the Early Dialogues

Socrates also appears to argue for, or directly makes a number of related psychological views:

All wrongdoing is done in ignorance, for everyone desires only what is good (Protagoras 352a-c; Gorgias 468b; Meno 77e-78b);
In some sense, everyone actually believes certain moral principles, even though some may think they do not have such beliefs, and may disavow them in argument (Gorgias 472b, 475e-476a).

e. Religious Positions in the Early Dialogues

In these dialogues, we also find Socrates represented as holding certain religious beliefs, such as:

The gods are completely wise and good (Apology 28a; Euthyphro 6a, 15a; Meno 99b-100b);
Ever since his childhood (see Apology 31d) Socrates has experienced a certain “divine something” (Apology 31c-d; 40a; Euthyphro 3b; see also Phaedrus 242b), which consists in a “voice” (Apology 31d; see also Phaedrus 242c), or “sign” (Apology 40c, 41d; Euthydemus 272e; see also Republic VI.496c; Phaedrus 242b) that opposes him when he is about to do something wrong (Apology 40a, 40c);
Various forms of divination can allow human beings to come to recognize the will of the gods (Apology 21a-23b, 33c);
Poets and rhapsodes are able to write and do the wonderful things they write and do, not from knowledge or expertise, but from some kind of divine inspiration. The same canbe said of diviners and seers, although they do seem to have some kind of expertise—perhaps only some technique by which to put them in a state of appropriate receptivity to the divine (Apology 22b-c; Laches 198e-199a; Ion 533d-536a, 538d-e; Meno 99c);
No one really knows what happens after death, but it is reasonable to think that death is not an evil; there may be an afterlife, in which the souls of the good are rewarded, and the souls of the wicked are punished (Apology 40c-41c; Crito 54b-c; Gorgias 523a-527a).

f. Methodological and Epistemological Positions in the Early Dialogues

In addition, Plato’s Socrates in the early dialogues may plausibly be regarded as having certain methodological or epistemological convictions, including:

Definitional knowledge of ethical terms is at least a necessary condition of reliable judging of specific instances of the values they name (Euthyphro 4e-5d, 6e; Laches 189e-190b; Lysis 223b; Greater Hippias 304d-e; Meno 71a-b, 100b; Republic I.354b-c);
A mere list of examples of some ethical value—even if all are authentic cases of that value—would never provide an adequate analysis of what the value is, nor would it provide an adequate definition of the value term that refers to the value. Proper definitions must state what is common to all examples of the value (Euthyphro 6d-e; Meno 72c-d);
Those with expert knowledge or wisdom on a given subject do not err in their judgments on that subject (Euthyphro 4e-5a; Euthydemus 279d-280b), go about their business in their area of expertise in a rational and regular way (Gorgias 503e-504b), and can teach and explain their subject (Gorgias 465a, 500e-501b, 514a-b; Laches 185b, 185e, 1889e-190b); Protagoras 319b-c).

6. The Middle Dialogues

a. Differences between the Early and Middle Dialogues

Scholarly attempts to provide relative chronological orderings of the early transitional and middle dialogues are problematical because all agree that the main dialogue of the middle period, the Republic, has several features that make dating it precisely especially difficult. As we have already said, many scholars count the first book of the Republic as among the early group of dialogues. But those who read the entire Republic will also see that the first book also provides a natural and effective introduction to the remaining books of the work. A recent study by Debra Nails (“The Dramatic Date of Plato’s Republic,” The Classical Journal 93.4, 1998, 383-396) notes several anachronisms that suggest that the process of writing (and perhaps re-editing) the work may have continued over a very long period. If this central work of the period is difficult to place into a specific context, there can be no great assurance in positioning any other works relative to this one.

Nonetheless, it does not take especially careful study of the transitional and middle period dialogues to notice clear differences in style and philosophical content from the early dialogues. The most obvious change is the way in which Plato seems to characterize Socrates: In the early dialogues, we find Socrates simply asking questions, exposing his interlocutors’ confusions, all the while professing his own inability to shed any positive light on the subject, whereas in the middle period dialogues, Socrates suddenly emerges as a kind of positive expert, willing to affirm and defend his own theories about many important subjects. In the early dialogues, moreover, Socrates discusses mainly ethical subjects with his interlocutors—with some related religious, methodological, and epistemological views scattered within the primarily ethical discussions. In the middle period, Plato’s Socrates’ interests expand outward into nearly every area of inquiry known to humankind. The philosophical positions Socrates advances in these dialogues are vastly more systematical, including broad theoretical inquiries into the connections between language and reality (in the Cratylus), knowledge and explanation (in the Phaedo and Republic, Books V-VII). Unlike the Socrates of the early period, who was the “wisest of men” only because he recognized the full extent of his own ignorance, the Socrates of the middle period acknowledges the possibility of infallible human knowledge (especially in the famous similes of light, the simile of the sun and good and the simile of the divided line in Book VI and the parable of the cave in Book VII of the Republic), and this becomes possible in virtue of a special sort of cognitive contact with the Forms or Ideas (eidê ), which exist in a supra-sensible realm available only to thought. This theory of Forms, introduced and explained in various contexts in each of the middle period dialogues, is perhaps the single best-known and most definitive aspect of what has come to be known as Platonism.

b. The Theory of Forms

In many of his dialogues, Plato mentions supra-sensible entities he calls “Forms” (or “Ideas”). So, for example, in the Phaedo, we are told that particular sensible equal things—for example, equal sticks or stones (see Phaedo 74a-75d)—are equal because of their “participation” or “sharing” in the character of the Form of Equality, which is absolutely, changelessly, perfectly, and essentially equal. Plato sometimes characterizes this participation in the Form as a kind of imaging, or approximation of the Form. The same may be said of the many things that are greater or smaller and the Forms of Great and Small (Phaedo 75c-d), or the many tall things and the Form of Tall (Phaedo 100e), or the many beautiful things and the Form of Beauty (Phaedo 75c-d, Symposium 211e, Republic V.476c). When Plato writes about instances of Forms “approximating” Forms, it is easy to infer that, for Plato, Forms are exemplars. If so, Plato believes that The Form of Beauty is perfect beauty, the Form of Justice is perfect justice, and so forth. Conceiving of Forms in this way was important to Plato because it enabled the philosopher who grasps the entities to be best able to judge to what extent sensible instances of the Forms are good examples of the Forms they approximate.

Scholars disagree about the scope of what is often called “the theory of Forms,” and question whether Plato began holding that there are only Forms for a small range of properties, such as tallness, equality, justice, beauty, and so on, and then widened the scope to include Forms corresponding to every term that can be applied to a multiplicity of instances. In the Republic, he writes as if there may be a great multiplicity of Forms—for example, in Book X of that work, we find him writing about the Form of Bed (see Republic X.596b). He may have come to believe that for any set of things that shares some property, there is a Form that gives unity to the set of things (and univocity to the term by which we refer to members of that set of things). Knowledge involves the recognition of the Forms (Republic V.475e-480a), and any reliable application of this knowledge will involve the ability to compare the particular sensible instantiations of a property to the Form.

c. Immortality and Reincarnation

In the early transitional dialogue, the Meno, Plato has Socrates introduce the Orphic and Pythagorean idea that souls are immortal and existed before our births. All knowledge, he explains, is actually recollected from this prior existence. In perhaps the most famous passage in this dialogue, Socrates elicits recollection about geometry from one of Meno’s slaves (Meno 81a-86b). Socrates’ apparent interest in, and fairly sophisticated knowledge of, mathematics appears wholly new in this dialogue. It is an interest, however, that shows up plainly in the middle period dialogues, especially in the middle books of the Republic.

Several arguments for the immortality of the soul, and the idea that souls are reincarnated into different life forms, are also featured in Plato’s Phaedo (which also includes the famous scene in which Socrates drinks the hemlock and utters his last words). Stylometry has tended to count the Phaedo among the early dialogues, whereas analysis of philosophical content has tended to place it at the beginning of the middle period. Similar accounts of the transmigration of souls may be found, with somewhat different details, in Book X of the Republic and in the Phaedrus, as well as in several dialogues of the late period, including the Timaeus and the Laws. No traces of the doctrine of recollection, or the theory of reincarnation or transmigration of souls, are to be found in the dialogues we listed above as those of the early period.

d. Moral Psychology

The moral psychology of the middle period dialogues also seems to be quite different from what we find in the early period. In the early dialogues, Plato’s Socrates is an intellectualist—that is, he claims that people always act in the way they believe is best for them (at the time of action, at any rate). Hence, all wrongdoing reflects some cognitive error. But in the middle period, Plato conceives of the soul as having (at least) three parts:

a rational part (the part that loves truth, which should rule over the other parts of the soul through the use of reason),
a spirited part (which loves honor and victory), and
an appetitive part (which desires food, drink, and sex),

and justice will be that condition of the soul in which each of these three parts “does its own work,” and does not interfere in the workings of the other parts (see esp. Republic IV.435b-445b). It seems clear from the way Plato describes what can go wrong in a soul, however, that in this new picture of moral psychology, the appetitive part of the soul can simply overrule reason’s judgments. One may suffer, in this account of psychology, from what is called akrasia or “moral weakness”—in which one finds oneself doing something that one actually believes is not the right thing to do (see especially Republic IV.439e-440b). In the early period, Socrates denied that akrasia was possible: One might change one’s mind at the last minute about what one ought to do—and could perhaps change one’s mind again later to regret doing what one has done—but one could never do what one actually believed was wrong, at the time of acting.

e. Critique of the Arts

The Republic also introduces Plato’s notorious critique of the visual and imitative arts. In the early period works, Socrates contends that the poets lack wisdom, but he also grants that they “say many fine things.” In the Republic, on the contrary, it seems that there is little that is fine in poetry or any of the other fine arts. Most of poetry and the other fine arts are to be censored out of existence in the “noble state” (kallipolis) Plato sketches in the Republic, as merely imitating appearances (rather than realities), and as arousing excessive and unnatural emotions and appetites (see esp. Republic X.595b-608b).

f. Platonic Love

In the Symposium, which is normally dated at the beginning of the middle period, and in the Phaedrus, which is dated at the end of the middle period or later yet, Plato introduces his theory of erôs (usually translated as “love”). Several passages and images from these dialogues continued to show up in Western culture—for example, the image of two lovers as being each other’s “other half,” which Plato assigns to Aristophanes in the Symposium. Also in that dialogue, we are told of the “ladder of love,” by which the lover can ascend to direct cognitive contact with (usually compared to a kind of vision of) Beauty Itself. In the Phaedrus, love is revealed to be the great “divine madness” through which the wings of the lover’s soul may sprout, allowing the lover to take flight to all of the highest aspirations and achievements possible for humankind. In both of these dialogues, Plato clearly regards actual physical or sexual contact between lovers as degraded and wasteful forms of erotic expression. Because the true goal of erôs is real beauty and real beauty is the Form of Beauty, what Plato calls Beauty Itself, erôs finds its fulfillment only in Platonic philosophy. Unless it channels its power of love into “higher pursuits,” which culminate in the knowledge of the Form of Beauty, erôs is doomed to frustration. For this reason, Plato thinks that most people sadly squander the real power of love by limiting themselves to the mere pleasures of physical beauty.

7. Late Transitional and Late Dialogues

a. Philosophical Methodology

One of the novelties of the dialogues after those of the middle period is the introduction of a new philosophical method. This method was introduced probably either late in the middle period or in the transition to the late period, but was increasingly important in the late period. In the early period dialogues, as we have said, the mode of philosophizing was refutative question-and-answer (called elenchos or the “Socratic method”). Although the middle period dialogues continue to show Socrates asking questions, the questioning in these dialogues becomes much more overtly leading and didactic. The highest method of philosophizing discussed in the middle period dialogues, called “dialectic,” is never very well explained (at best, it is just barely sketched in the divided line image at the end of Book VI of the Republic). The correct method for doing philosophy, we are now told in the later works, is what Plato identifies as “collection and division,” which is perhaps first referred to at Phaedrus 265e. In this method, the philosopher collects all of the instances of some generic category that seem to have common characteristics, and then divides them into specific kinds until they cannot be further subdivided. This method is explicitly and extensively on display in the Sophist, Statesman, and Philebus.

b. Critique of the Earlier Theory of Forms

One of the most puzzling features of the late dialogues is the strong suggestion in them that Plato has reconsidered his theory of Forms in some way. Although there seems still in the late dialogues to be a theory of Forms (although the theory is, quite strikingly, wholly unmentioned in the Theaetetus, a later dialogue on the nature of knowledge), where it does appear in the later dialogues, it seems in several ways to have been modified from its conception in the middle period works. Perhaps the most dramatic signal of such a change in the theory appears first in the Parmenides, which appears to subject the middle period version of the theory to a kind of “Socratic” refutation, only this time, the main refuter is the older Eleatic philosopher Parmenides, and the hapless victim of the refutation is a youthful Socrates. The most famous (and apparently fatal) of the arguments provided by Parmenides in this dialogue has come to be known as the “Third Man Argument,” which suggests that the conception of participation (by which individual objects take on the characters of the Forms) falls prey to an infinite regress: If individual male things are male in virtue of participation in the Form of Man, and the Form of Man is itself male, then what is common to both The Form of Man and the particular male things must be that they all participate in some (other) Form, say, Man 2. But then, if Man 2 is male, then what it has in common with the other male things is participation in some further Form, Man 3, and so on. That Plato’s theory is open to this problem gains support from the notion, mentioned above, that Forms are exemplars. If the Form of Man is itself a (perfect) male, then the Form shares a property in common with the males that participate in it. But since the Theory requires that for any group of entities with a common property, there is a Form to explain the commonality, it appears that the theory does indeed give rise to the vicious regress.

There has been considerable controversy for many years over whether Plato believed that the Theory of Forms was vulnerable to the “Third Man” argument, as Aristotle believed it was, and so uses the Parmenides to announce his rejection of the Theory of Forms, or instead believed that the Third Man argument can be avoided by making adjustments to the Theory of Forms. Of relevance to this discussion is the relative dating of the Timaeus and the Parmenides, since the Theory of Forms very much as it appears in the middle period works plays a prominent role in the Timaeus. Thus, the assignment of a later date to the Timaeus shows that Plato did not regard the objection to the Theory of Forms raised in the Parmenides as in any way decisive. In any event, it is agreed on all sides that Plato’s interest in the Theory shifted in the Sophist and Stateman to the exploration of the logical relations that hold between abstract entities. In the Laws, Plato’s last (and unfinished) work, the Theory of Forms appears to have dropped out altogether. Whatever value Plato believed that knowledge of abstract entities has for the proper conduct of philosophy, he no longer seems to have believed that such knowledge is necessary for the proper running of a political community.

c. The “Eclipse” of Socrates

In several of the late dialogues, Socrates is even further marginalized. He is either represented as a mostly mute bystander (in the Sophist and Statesman), or else absent altogether from the cast of characters (in the Laws and Critias). In the Theaetetus and Philebus, however, we find Socrates in the familiar leading role. The so-called “eclipse” of Socrates in several of the later dialogues has been a subject of much scholarly discussion.

d. The Myth of Atlantis

Plato’s famous myth of Atlantis is first given in the Timaeus, which scholars now generally agree is quite late, despite being dramatically placed on the day after the discussion recounted in the Republic. The myth of Atlantis is continued in the unfinished dialogue intended to be the sequel to the Timaeus, the Critias.

e. The Creation of the Universe

The Timaeus is also famous for its account of the creation of the universe by the Demiurge. Unlike the creation by the God of medieval theologians, Plato’s Demiurge does not create ex nihilo, but rather orders the cosmos out of chaotic elemental matter, imitating the eternal Forms. Plato takes the four elements, fire, air, water, and earth (which Plato proclaims to be composed of various aggregates of triangles), making various compounds of these into what he calls the Body of the Universe. Of all of Plato’s works, the Timaeus provides the most detailed conjectures in the areas we now regard as the natural sciences: physics, astronomy, chemistry, and biology.

f. The Laws

In the Laws, Plato’s last work, the philosopher returns once again to the question of how a society ought best to be organized. Unlike his earlier treatment in the Republic, however, the Laws appears to concern itself less with what a best possible state might be like, and much more squarely with the project of designing a genuinely practicable, if admittedly not ideal, form of government. The founders of the community sketched in the Laws concern themselves with the empirical details of statecraft, fashioning rules to meet the multitude of contingencies that are apt to arise in the “real world” of human affairs. A work of enormous length and complexity, running some 345 Stephanus pages, the Laws was unfinished at the time of Plato’s death. According to Diogenes Laertius (3.37), it was left written on wax tablets.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Greek Texts

Platonis Opera (in 5 volumes) – The Oxford Classical Texts (Oxford: Oxford University Press):
Volume I (E. A. Duke et al., eds., 1995): Euthyphro, Apologia Socratis, Crito, Phaedo, Cratylus, Theaetetus, Sophista, Politicus.
Volume II (John Burnet, ed., 1901): Parmenides, Philebus, Symposium, Phaedrus, Alcibiades I, Alcibiades II, Hipparchus, Amatores.
Volume III (John Burnet, ed., 1903): Theages, Charmides, Laches, Lysis, Euthydemus, Protagoras, Gorgias, Meno, Hippias Maior, Hippias Minor, Io, Menexenus.
Volume IV (John Burnet, ed., 1978): Clitopho, Respublica, Timaeus, Critias.
Volume V (John Burnet, ed. 1907): Minos, Leges, Epinomis, Epistulae, Definitiones, De Iusto, De Virtute, Demodocus, Sisyphus, Eryxias, Axiochus.
- The Oxford Classical Texts are the standard Greek texts of Plato’s works, including all of the spuria and dubia except for the epigrams, the Greek texts of which may be found in Hermann Beckby (ed.), Anthologia Graeca (Munich: Heimeran, 1957).

b. Translations into English

Cooper, J. M. (ed.), Plato: Complete Works (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1997).
- Contains very recent translations of all of the Platonic works, dubia, spuria, and epigrams. Now generally regarded as the standard for English translations.

c. Plato’s Socrates and the Historical Socrates

Kahn, Charles H., Plato and the Socratic Dialogue (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996).
- Kahn’s own version of the “unitarian” reading of Plato’s dialogues. Although scholars have not widely accepted Kahn’s positions, Kahn offers several arguments for rejecting the more established held “developmentalist” position.
Vlastos, Gregory, Socrates, Ironist and Moral Philosopher (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press and Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press, 1991).
- Chapters 2 and 3 of this book are invariably cited as providing the most influential recent arguments for the “historicist” version of the “developmentalist” position.

d. Socrates and Plato’s Early Period Dialogues

Benson, Hugh H. (ed.), Essays on the Philosophy of Socrates (New York: Oxford University Press, 1992).
- A collection of previously published articles by various authors on Socrates and Plato’s early dialogues.
Brickhouse, Thomas C. and Nicholas D. Smith, Plato’s Socrates (New York: Oxford University Press, 1994).
- Six chapters, each on different topics in the study of Plato’s early or Socratic dialogues.
Brickhouse, Thomas C. and Nicholas D. Smith, The Philosophy of Socrates (Boulder: Westview, 2000).
- Seven chapters, each on different topics in the study of Plato’s early or Socratic dialogues. Some changes in views from those offered in their 1994 book.
Prior, William (ed.), Socrates: Critical Assessments (London and New York, 1996) in four volumes: I: The Socratic Problem and Socratic Ignorance; II: Issues Arising from the Trial of Socrates; III: Socratic Method; IV: Happiness and Virtue.
- A collection of previously published articles by various authors on Socrates and Plato’s early dialogues.
Santas, Gerasimos Xenophon, Socrates: Philosophy in Plato’s Early Dialogues (Boston and London: Routledge, 1979).
- Eight chapters, each on different topics in the study of Plato’s early or Socratic dialogues.
Taylor, C. C. W. Socrates: A Very Short Introduction (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998).
- Very short, indeed, but nicely written and generally very reliable.
Vlastos, Gregory, Socrates, Ironist and Moral Philosopher (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press and Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press, 1991). (Also cited in VIII.3, above.)
- Eight chapters, each on different topics in the study of Plato’s early or Socratic dialogues.
Vlastos, Gregory, Socratic Studies (ed. Myles Burnyeat; Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994).
- Edited and published after Vlastos’s death. A collection of Vlastos’s papers on Socrates not published in Vlastos’s 1991 book.
Vlastos, Gregory (ed.) The Philosophy of Socrates (South Bend: University of Notre Dame Press, 1980).
- A collection of papers by various authors on Socrates and Plato’s early dialogues. Although now somewhat dated, several articles in this collection continue to be widely cited and studied.

e. General Books on Plato

Cherniss, Harold, The Riddle of the Early Academy (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1945).
- A study of reports in the Early Academy, following Plato’s death, of the so-called “unwritten doctrines” of Plato.
Fine, Gail (ed.), Plato I: Metaphysics and Epistemology and Plato II: Ethics, Politics, Religion and the Soul (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999).
- A collection of previously published papers by various authors, mostly on Plato’s middle and later periods.
Grote, George, Plato and the Other Companions of Sokrates 2nd ed. 3 vols. (London: J. Murray, 1867).
- 3-volume collection with general discussion of “the Socratics” other than Plato, as well as specific discussions of each of Plato’s works.
Guthrie, W. K. C., A History of Greek Philosophy (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press) vols. 3 (1969), 4 (1975) and 5 (1978).
- Volume 3 is on the Sophists and Socrates; volume 4 is on Plato’s early dialogues and continues with chapters on Phaedo, Symposium, and Phaedrus, and then a final chapter on the Republic.
Irwin, Terence, Plato’s Ethics (New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995).
- Systematic discussion of the ethical thought in Plato’s works.
Kraut, Richard (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Plato (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992).
- A collection of original discussions of various general topics about Plato and the dialogues.
Smith, Nicholas D. (ed.), Plato: Critical Assessments (London and New York: Routledge, 1998) in four volumes: I: General Issues of Interpretation; II: Plato’s Middle Period: Metaphysics and Epistemology; III: Plato’s Middle Period: Psychology and Value Theory; IV: Plato’s Later Works.
- A collection of previously published articles by various authors on interpretive problems and on Plato’s middle and later periods. Plato’s early period dialogues are covered in this series by Prior 1996 (see VIII.4).
Vlastos, Gregory, Platonic Studies 2nd ed. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1981).
- A collection of Vlastos’s papers on Plato, including some important earlier work on the early dialogues.
Vlastos, Gregory, Plato I: Metaphysics and Epistemology and Plato II: Ethics, Politics, and Philosophy of Art and Religion (South Bend: University of Notre Dame Press, 1987).
- A collection of papers by various authors on Plato’s middle period and later dialogues. Although now somewhat dated, several articles in this collection continue to be widely cited and studied.

Author Information

Thomas Brickhouse
Email: brickhouse@lynchburg.edu
Lynchburg College
U. S. A.

and

Nicholas D. Smith
Email: ndsmith@lclark.edu
Lewis & Clark College
U. S. A.

Christian Philosophy: The 1930s French Debates

Between 1931 and 1935, important debates regarding the nature, possibility and history of Christian philosophy took place between major authors in French-speaking philosophical and theological circles. These authors include Etienne Gilson, Jacques Maritain, Maurice Blondel, Gabriel Marcel, Fernand Van Steenberghen and Antonin Sertillanges. The debates provided occasion for participants to clarify their positions on the relationships between philosophy, Christianity, theology and history, and they involved issues such as the relationship between faith and reason, the nature of reason, reason’s grounding in the concrete human subject, the problem of the supernatural, and the nature and ends of philosophy itself. The debates led participants to self-consciously re-evaluate their own philosophical commitments and address the problem of philosophy’s nature in a novel and rigorous manner.

Although these debates originally took place between Roman Catholics and secular Rationalists, fundamental differences between different Roman Catholic positions rapidly became apparent and assumed central importance. The debates also drew attention from Reformed Protestant thinkers. Eventually the debates sparked smaller discussions among scholars in English, German, Spanish, Portuguese and Italian-speaking circles, and these continue to the present day. This article provides a brief overview of the most important contributors, the central issues and the main positions of these debates.

Introduction
The Historical Background and Development of the Debates
Positions Against Christian Philosophy
Positions For Christian Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The use of the term “Christian philosophy” and other similar expressions dates back to the early Christian era. However, considerable ambiguity surrounding the term pervades philosophical reflection regarding Christian philosophy’s possibility, historical reality and nature, and therefore affects efforts to generate and evaluate particular Christian philosophies. The 1930s French Debates represent a period of the most sustained and systematic examination of the problems concerning Christian philosophy, and are thus of philosophical significance for various reasons.

First, they involve perennial issues raised in philosophy, including the relationships between faith and reason, philosophy and theology, the nature of human reason and its limits in the face of religion, the nature of religion, historical relationships between Christian thought, practice and the development of particular philosophical systems and the nature of philosophy itself. The debates led participants to self-consciously re-evaluate their own philosophical commitments and address the problem of philosophy’s nature in a novel and rigorous manner.

Second, the debates are momentous due to the renown of their participants, most of whom had earned significant places in Francophone philosophical establishments, both secular or Christian. Practically all of the major interlocutors approached the issues armed with years of previous study, reflection and in some cases polemical engagements. Each of them was thus able to develop further insights and to more systematically elaborate their positions during the ensuing debates on the basis of their previous philosophical work.

Third, the debates and their participants’ personal positions on Christian philosophy have generated an ever-growing philosophical literature. Given that issues germane to Christian philosophy had never before nor since been examined so thoroughly, contemporary discussions regarding Christian philosophy greatly benefit from the 1930s Debates.

2. The Historical Background and Development of the Debates

Without providing a comprehensive historic overview for the 1930s Debates, several historical developments allowing context are to be considered at this juncture.

The onset of modernity produced radically new schools of philosophical thought, increasingly secularized culture, institutions, disciplines and discourses, and in some cases suspicion or outright repudiation of previous philosophical and theological traditions, religious authority and of Christianity itself. While issues raised by the contact between Christianity and philosophy were addressed in late antiquity, the “problem of Christian philosophy” was not explicitly framed until these developments came about. Thus Christian philosophy became a central problem for 17th and 18th century thinkers such as Pascal, Malebranche, Descartes, Hegel, Kierkegaard, Catholic Traditionalists (such as de Maistre and Lammenais), neo-Scholastics and other Thomists, and Maurice Blondel.

Another major development stemmed from the impetus given to Catholic philosophical work by several papal encyclicals. Leo XIII’s Aeterni Patris dealt explicitly with the relationship between philosophy and Christianity, and exhorted the return to study of Thomas Aquinas. While it never made Thomism the official philosophy of the Roman Catholic Church, it gave pride of place to Aquinas’ work, and within a generation Thomist philosophy became established as the dominant and representative form of Catholic philosophical thought. Aeterni Patris also had the side-effect of encouraging renewed attention to other mediaeval Christian thinkers, including Augustine, Anselm, Bonaventure, Scotus and Ockham. During the Modernism crisis, Pius X’s Pascendi exerted a different effect. The document diagnosed philosophical bases of the heresy of “modernism” and reinforced the centrality to be accorded to Thomism. With respect to Christian philosophy, the two documents might be summarized thus: the first suggested where Christian philosophy should be found and further developed; the second indicated where Christian philosophy could not be found and further developed.

Furthermore, in France a revitalization had taken place in metaphysics, moral philosophy and philosophical anthropology (all areas, as Etienne Gilson pointed out, central to Christian philosophy), due in part to renewed interest in Thomist and Augustinian studies and also to the influence of Henri Bergson and Maurice Blondel. In addition, the term “Christian philosophy” began to enjoy greater currency in the early part of the 20th century, particularly by the 1920s. This engendered two main lines of thought. First, the Debates provoked counter-responses by both secular, rationalist philosophers and by Catholic, neo-Scholastic philosophers who agreed for different reasons that the notion of Christian philosophy was a false one. Second, they produced reflection and dialogue on the part of Catholic and Reformed Protestant philosophers who considered the term to designate a distinctively Christian manner of philosophizing. By the time the debates officially began at the March 1931 meeting of the Société Française de Philosophie, the issue was primed for sustained discussion by the Francophone philosophical and theological communities.

Several participants had articulated their views on Christian philosophy prior to the debates. Emile Bréher dismissed the idea of Christian philosophy in relevant portions of his History of Philosophy, and in 1928 presented his argument at a set of conferences in Belgium. Etienne Gilson published books on Augustine, Bonaventure and Aquinas, making use of the term “Christian philosophy.” Along with Blondel and Jacques Maritain, she contributed discussions of Christian philosophy to various works commemorating the 1,500 year anniversary of the death of Augustine.

The specific catalyst for the debates was Xavier Leon’s proposal to Gilson that he and Léon Brunscvicg should debate the status of Thomist philosophy as a philosophy. Gilson in return proposed the broader topic “Christian philosophy”, asking that Brehier be included. Maritain also participated, taking Gilson’s side. Blondel contributed a letter highly critical of Gilson’s position at the meeting, and published a response to Bréhier’s criticisms.

The Debates expanded in numerous forums over the next four years. Articles and conference contributions by around fifty different authors appeared in journals, at first mainly in French, then later in German, Italian, Spanish, English and even Latin. Gilson, Maritain, Blondel and Regis Jolivet each published books focused on Christian philosophy in 1931-33. The Société Thomiste devoted their 1933 conference to the topic of Christian philosophy, and the Société d’Etudes Philosophiques devoted theirs that same year to discussion of Blondel’s Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne. By around 1936, the Debates came to a close. Although they did not end in conclusive or universally acknowledged success for any of the participants, the positions of dominant schools of thought regarding Christian philosophy had been firmly established.

The issue of Christian philosophy has continued to spur philosophical reflection, taking literary form in conference presentations, articles, books and papal documents (e.g. John Paul II’s Fides et Ratio and Benedict XVI’s recent Regensburg address on Faith, Reason and the University) and motivating a number of conferences and special journal volumes devoted to the topic. One smaller and later set of debates worth noting took place in the late 1940s and early 50s among Francophone Reformed Protestant philosophers and theologians, inspired by Roger Mehl’s The Condition of the Christian Philosopher, and included several Reformed thinkers who had played minor roles in the 1930s debates – Jacques Bois, Pierre Guérin and Arnold Reymond.

3. Positions Against Christian Philosophy

a. Gilson’s Overview

Etienne Gilson provides a useful overview and typology of the positions opposed to the possibility of Christian philosophy, distinguishing three main stances: “theologism” (now more generally called “fideism”), “rationalism” and certain types of Neo-Scholasticism.

Gilson had originally singled out “certain doctors of the Middle Ages” as representatives of theologism, for whom

the Christian religion excludes philosophy, because Christianity is a doctrine of salvation, because one can be saved without philosophy, and even because it is more difficult to be saved with philosophy than without it. . . . Medieval philosophy was the negation of this obscurantism, but still it did exist. For men of that type, the very notion of Christian philosophy could only rest on an equivocation. It signifies that where Christianity is, it is useless or dangerous that philosophy be. (Bulletin de la Société française de Philosophie, p. 41)

Gilson’s later works (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy and Christianity and Philosophy ) expand this position, engaging the thought of Luther, Calvin and their later interpreters.

Gilson also criticizes another position regarding “theologism” (The Unity of Philosophical Experience, p.31-60): this is one where the term “Christian philosophy” signifies Christian revelation or Christian theology, disregarding the distinct role, discipline and methods of philosophy. In certain respects the rationalist position mirrors the theologist one:

[W]here philosophy is, it is dangerous that Christianity should be. This is the position of pure rationalism, i.e., of those who do not accept a limited role for rationalism. Whatever the content may be of the diverse philosophies reason elaborates, it is insofar as rational that they are philosophies. To want to subordinate them to a dogma or to a faith is to destroy philosophy’s essence….[T]heology bases itself on faith, which is something irrational. To make philosophy the servant of theology is therefore to make the rational depend on the irrational, i.e, to suppress its very rationality. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 41)

At their root, rationalist positions on Christian philosophy, on one ground or another, eliminate or exclude from the field of philosophy any philosophical system, doctrine or author who brings reason, the instrument of philosophy, into contaminating contact with religious faith, practice, or thought, which would vitiate the philosophy’s rational and autonomous development. Numerous philosophical positions, schools, or even environments of basic cultural and philosophical presuppositions developed during or in the wake of the European Enlightenment fit rationalism’s profile. Arguably, even philosophies critical of the Enlightenment but devotedly committed to a necessarily secularist view of philosophy can, on the issue of Christian philosophy, be regarded as analogues of rationalism.

From rationalist perspectives, Patristic and Medieval thought, as well as those of their modern interpreters, would not legitimately deserve the title of philosophy. Gilson notes, however, holding that “everything that either directly or indirectly undergoes the influence of a religious faith ceases, ipso facto, to retain any philosophical value,” really stems from and represents “a mere ‘rationalist’ postulate, directly opposed to reason.” (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, p. 406)

Despite their differences, Neo-Thomist or neo-Scholastic opponents of Christian philosophy also shared several key similarities with rationalists. As Gilson points out, neo-Scholastics retain some role for Christian faith, but one extrinsic to their philosophical activity:

[A]ll of them agree with Saint Thomas that truth cannot contradict truth and that, consequently, what faith finds agrees substantially with what reason proves. They would even go further, for if faith agrees with reason, if not in its method, at least in its content, all factual disagreement between the two is an indication of an error in the philosophical order and a warning that one has to reexamine the problem. Still, all of the neo-Scholastic philosophers add that, insofar as philosophy, philosophy is the exclusive work of reason. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 42)

The philosophy of the Christian, in their view, ought not to incorporate anything deriving from Christianity into itself, for then it passes over into theology. The neo-Scholastic position in effect adopts wholesale rationalist assumptions about human reason, philosophy and Christian faith, with the consequence that

[a]ccording to these neo-Scholastic philosophers, there cannot be Christian philosophy any more than there can be for a pure rationalist, because within the philosophical order, grasped with precision and insofar as philosophical, their rationalism is a pure one. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 42)

b. Theologist (Fideist) Positions

No thinker ascribing to Gilson’s description of theologism participated in the debates, with the possible exception of Lev Shestov, whose 1937 Athens and Jerusalem (a portion of which was published in 1935) may be described as advancing theologism. Still, fideism exercised a role in the debates by providing a counter-position to argue against. Gilson himself cited a number of past examples, including Tertullian, Peter Damian, the Franciscan spirituals, the Imitation of Christ’s anonymous author, Martin Luther and briefly discussed Karl Barth (Christianity and Philosophy, p. 44-48), remarking: “All the Barthian Calvinist asks of philosophy is that it recognize itself as damned and remain in that condition” (Christianity and Philosophy, p. 47).

Barth exercised considerable influence in Francophone Reformed Christian circles, and his thought would figure heavily in later 1940s-50s Reformed Protestant discussions about Christian philosophy, but he was not particularly well-known or engaged in French Catholic circles at the time of the debates. His perspective on philosophy and Christianity is clearly and rigorously fideist, holding that Christian philosophy is an impossibility since philosophy and Christian Revelation have essentially nothing in common. Philosophy, like human reason, remains fundamentally incapable of addressing an absolutely transcendent Christian revelation of Christ, which alone provides knowledge of and relation to God:

There never actually has been a philosophia christiana, for if it was philosophia it was not christiana, and if it was christiana it was not philosophia. (Church Dogmatics, v. 1 , p. 6)

The existentialist Jewish philosopher Lev Shestov provides an example of the theologist position, in which his central metaphor is the opposition (stemming from the Genesis narrative) between the Tree of Life, representing faith and human thought working by the guidance of faith, and the Tree of Knowledge of Good and Evil, identified with the temptations of human reason and philosophy. According to Shestov, important and basic dimensions of human existence are left behind, reductively misconstrued, or overlooked by reason and philosophy. By aiming at and striving for knowledge, philosophy attempts to draw everything into a rationalist universal system of necessity and restraint. Even when making autonomy a goal, philosophy turns out to be unable to maintain itself and its drive to dominate all it encounters within limits, so that it corrupts and distorts human freedom and renders the human being unable to adequately understand itself, God and faith.

Shestov criticizes Gilson specifically, summarizing the latter’s position as proposing

the revealed truth is founded on nothing, proves nothing, is justified before nothing, and – despite this – is transformed in our mind into a justified, demonstrated, self-evident truth. Metaphysics wishes to possess the revealed truth and it succeeds in doing so. (Athens and Jerusalem, p.271)

Shestov regards Gilson’s position on Christian philosophy, and those of the Medieval thinkers from whom Gilson takes inspiration, as more sophisticated, and therefore more dangerous, versions of the same rationalist movement involved in ancient and modern philosophy. As an alternative, he proposes a “Biblical” or “Judeo-Christian philosophy,” departing from norms of Western philosophy, accepting “neither the fundamental problems nor the principles nor the technique of thought of rational philosophy,” open to and taking its direction from the dimension of faith.

c. Rationalist Positions

Two major representatives of the rationalist position, the historian of philosophy Emile Bréhier, and the idealist Léon Brunschvicg, became directly involved in the Debates. Interestingly, while both argued against the possibility of Christian philosophy, their positions differed on basic assumptions about rationality. After presenting his position prior to and early on in the debates, Bréhier never provided responses to the arguments of his critics. In his later Raison et Religion, Brunchscvicg revisited the issues, but made no new contribution. By the middle stages of the Debates, the rationalists dropped out of the discussion, which had turned to intra-Christian (primarily intra-Catholic) issues.

Bréhier’s concluded that “one can no more speak of a Christian philosophy than of a Christian mathematics or a Christian physics,” (“Y-a-t’il une philosophie chrétienne?”, p. 162) arriving at this via two main argumentative strategies. Before examining these, two points bearing on Bréhier’s contribution to the debate require mention. First, Bréhier suggests that “the difficulty here is more normative than factual,” and then writes decisively “[t]he question of the existence of Christian philosophy can not be a pure question of fact.” (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 133-4). Judgment and resolution requires the historian’s active work of interpreting and discerning the philosophical value and content of candidates for the legitimate title of Christian philosophy. Second, he identifies reason, and rationality as such, with an idealization of Greek philosophy:

For the Hellene, the true object of philosophy was to discover order, or the cosmos: each being (and principally the directive forces of nature, souls, and God) must be defined by the exact, and ne varietur, place that it occupies in this eternal order. (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 134)

[T]he goal of Greek philosophy was to investigate the rational, consequently immovable and fixed, order which is in things. The universal Logos or Intelligence is only the metaphysical realization, the projection of this need. It is, set up within the ideal, the very order that the sensible world realizes more or less imperfectly. (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 139-40)

Bréhier’s first argumentative strategy took the form of a dilemma: there are two possible ways of understanding Christian philosophy, and adopting either one of these will lead to a rejection of Christian philosophy as philosophy:

The word “Christian philosophy” seems to me to have two extremely distinct senses….In a first sense, it exists, but it is of no interest to philosophers; in a second sense, it would have interest for philosophers if it did exist, but it does not exist. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 49)

In the first sense, Christianity is determined by some dogmatic authority, termed by Bréhier a “magisterium.”

[T]he only way to know what is Christian and what is not Christian is to consult those who say – and who have the right to say – what Christian doctrine is….In this sense, I will call “Christian philosophy” that which is in agreement with dogma, what the magisterium accepts. I will call “non-Christian philosophy” that which it rejects, and I will say that this question has not a bit of importance or interest for the philosopher as philosopher. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 50)

He provides two main and related reasons why the philosopher may set this question aside. Besides the fact of the existence of numerous Christian communities disagreeing on fundamental issues, the history of the Catholic magisterium reveals

an absence of precise limit in the philosophical domain this magisterium oversees, and a lack of consistency in its censure, and these make Christian philosophy in the first sense seem to be something completely arbitrary. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 50)

In addition, the mere condition of reason and philosophy being forced in its exercise to submit to any authority sets

in place of the autonomy of reason that takes the initiative of philosophical thought, the heteronomy of a reason completely incapable of directing itself and knowing the scope of its own conclusions. (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 150)

This irredeemably vitiates any Christian philosophy understood in the first sense.

In the second sense, Christian philosophy would be a historically observable case where Christianity has provided to philosophy a new concept, method or direction. Arguing against this, Bréhier examined the thought of the Church Fathers, Augustine, Thomas Aquinas, 17th Century Rationalists, 19th Century Traditionalists, Hegel and his successors, and Maurice Blondel, to show that none of them are both Christian and philosophical. The Church Fathers do not create a new philosophy, but rather “annex everything they can from pagan philosophy to Christianity” (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 135). What is philosophical in Augustine really comes from Plato and Plotinus, and likewise Aquinas’ philosophy is simply Aristotelianism, though marred by an additional problem:

Saint Thomas’ goal is to show the convergence of the two great movements that dominate the spiritual history of our West, Greek rationalism represented by Aristotle and Christian faith. One can only speak of convergence if each of these two movements has its own initiative, its own internal development: but, reason no longer possesses its own initiative once the results of its own activity are judged by a criterion that is foreign to it, by faith (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 144).

The 17th Century Rationalists develop a natural theology, but in the process dispense with any distinctive dependence on Christianity, while the Traditionalists render reason so entirely dependent on Christianity that

If ‘reason’ still retains some value, it is under the condition of not wanting to be anything more than a form of tradition, and its oldest aspect. This Christian philosophy, the better to dominate reason, annexes it thus into revelation (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 156)

Hegelianism rationalizes religion by absorbing it into philosophy, and eventually culminates in Feuerbach’s philosophical but atheist humanism. Bréhier then brings his review to a close in criticizing Blondel on two counts. First, the problem of action central to Blondel’s work has no intrinsic connection with Christianity. Second, Blondel’s work is really just an example of Christian apologetics rather than philosophy.

In contrast to Bréhier’s wholesale and unconvincing dismissal of any historical influence of Christianity on philosophy, Brunschvicg provides a more nuanced, though still largely negative, perspective on Christian philosophy. While acknowledging from the start that “I would not recognize myself in what I think and what I feel if the entire movement of Christianity had not existed,” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 73) he would sharpen the debates’ question into that of “a specifically Christian philosophy” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 73). His answer takes form within the general assumptions of Brunschvicg’s evolutionary and idealist philosophy of rationality’s development.

In his view, rationality and philosophy emerge from originally religious backgrounds, but become progressively freed from religion and immature forms of rationality. True spirituality is to be discovered in philosophy, since religion and religious thought provide only its symbols.

[W]e come back to the position that I have called, granted very naively, that of the Western consciousness, which is prior by five centuries to the blossoming of Christianity. From that point of view, faith, insofar as faith, is only the prefiguration, the sensible symbol, the approximation of what properly human effort will be able to set in full light. We understand then how one can recognize that philosophy exists, and Christianity exists, without having the right to conclude that a Christian philosophy would exist (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 74-5).

Brunschvicg’s rationalist perspective eliminates one key aspect of the problem Christian philosophy poses for his Christian interlocutors. He holds that revelation is not really revelation, since what philosophy’s gradually ascending progress has revealed is that there is in reality no supernatural: Christian or otherwise. He also eliminates from consideration all pre-17th century philosophies as candidates for Christian philosophy, arguing that from the vantage of the present, the types of rationality developed prior to the 17th century were immature, and thus not adequately philosophical. Significantly, while this would disqualify Augustine’s or Aquinas’ thought (though not Hegel’s or Blondel’s) from being Christian philosophies, it would likewise disqualify the ancient conception of reason upon which Bréhier’s critique entirely relies.

There are three possible relations between a thinker’s philosophy and Christianity in Brunschvicg’s view. If one is primarily a philosopher and secondarily a Christian, it is not really Christian philosophy, just philosophy. Likewise if one is primarily a Christian and secondarily a philosopher, it is not really Christian philosophy. Pascal provides an example of this, where “his Christianity has truly taken possession of the entire man… by uncovering for him a way of philosophizing that is not that of philosophers” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., 76). There is a third possibility

where we would have to recognize that there is something it would be appropriate to call, without equivocation and without compromise, a Christian philosophy. This is the case where a metaphysician, reflecting in a manner deep and “naive” at the same time, would arrive at that conviction that philosophy ends up only posing problems, entangling itself in difficulties. The clearer a consciousness it will have of these problems, the deeper it will sound the abyss into which these difficulties throw philosophy, the more it will be persuaded that only Christianity’s own solutions will satisfy philosophical problems. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., 76).

Brunschvicg identifies this possibility with Malebranche (arguably, Blondel would also fit this description), and concedes to him

the privilege and the honor of being the representative, naturally not the sole representative, but the typical and essential representative of a Christian philosophy (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., 76).

d. Neo-Scholastic Positions

Certain neo-Scholastic philosophers and theologians (in particular those representing the Louvain school), while regarding Thomism as the truest and most adequate philosophy available, argued against the possibility or desirability of an explicitly Christian philosophy. Several concerns marked their position, not least of which was maintaining strict distinction between the disciplines of philosophy and theology, whose formulation in their eyes was a central accomplishment of Thomas Aquinas’ thought. Philosophy was to be, indeed could only be, an activity deriving from and employing only purely natural reason, evidence and principles, distinct from theology in which Christian revelation and faith play a role. Neo-Scholastics worried over any implication that human reason might not be essentially the same in the non-believer as in the believer, especially since this would seem to render discussion and comparison with non-Christian philosophies problematic. Their rallying point was the view that Thomism was a genuine philosophy precisely because it was a purely rational philosophy, independently arriving at coincidence with the truths of Christian faith and doctrine.

Pierre Mandonnet adopted the most extreme position, arguing at the 1933 Société Thomiste meeting for a historical interpretation reminiscent of Bréhier’s:

Certainly Christianity has transformed the world, but it has not transformed philosophy….Certainly Christianity has been a considerable factor of progress in humanity, but not progress of a philosophical order. Progress in the philosophical order does not take place by Scripture but by reason….Progress in philosophy therefore does not take place by the paths of religion. Even if there had been neither Revelation nor Incarnation, there would have been development of science and of thought. (La philosophie chrétienne: Juvisy, 11 Septembre 1933, p. 67-8)

He granted that one might speak of Christian philosophy as “a Christian philosophical product,” i.e., the product of the philosophical activity of philosophers who happen to be Christian.

But, this will be a purely personal matter. They have their reasons when they philosophize; they have their reasons for being Christian. The unity is in the subject, who finds himself being a believer and a philosopher; it is not in the work that they produce. (p. 63)

At any rate, Mandonnet avers, the purported Christian philosopher will not be engaging in philosophy, but rather a theology, which can neither be unified with philosophy, nor be made comprehensible to non-believers.

Léon Noël’s position, articulated through recourse both to Aquinas’ thought and to Husserlian phenomenology, demonstrates more flexibility than Mandonnet’s, and distinguishes between two points of view: that of the systematic philosopher, and that of the genesis of a philosophical system. From the former, in its exposition, a philosophy must be entirely rational, free from faith, so that it “rest[s] only on evidence” and remains “purely philosophical, communicable to any other mind, even if it be an unbelieving one, and able to be discussed on the common ground of certainties which all grant.” (“La notion de philosophie chrétienne”, p. 340). From the latter, Christianity can orient or aid the process of study, the development of a philosophical position or doctrine, and does so in and for the individual philosopher:

Christian doctrines do not enter as such into the objective exposition of a philosophy, or then that philosophy would cease to be a philosophy. They cannot serve as such for the basis of a reasoning. But their presence in the mind of the believer can orient the research with a new meaning. (“La notion”, p. 339-40)

In this limited sense, regarding a philosophy whose historical development took place through the influence of Christianity, Noël grants, we can speak of a Christian philosophy, but this is a less rigorous way of speaking and thinking. He maintains that the Christian philosopher who has been aided by Christianity in his or her philosophical research must then strive to remove any dependence on Christian faith or doctrine in their philosophical system, so that it is purely rational, as accessible to the non-believer as it is to his religious counterpart. A “transcendent aspect” will remain in Christian faith, life, and experience, and adequate study of this will require “subordinating one’s judgment to faith,” but this will then cross over the boundary from philosophy into theology. All the philosopher can do, as a philosopher, is note this aspect’s “irreducibility to rational explanation” (“La notion de philosophie chrétienne”, p. 342).

Fernand Van Steenberghen makes points analogous to those made by Noël and Mandonnet (though mildly criticizing the latter), agreeing with them in regarding the term “Christian philosophy” as either the product of, or liable to produce, misunderstandings.

There are Christian philosophers, because some Christians can give themselves over to philosophical research, and because their Christianity disposes them to give themselves over with perspicuity, with prudence, with serenity; it helps them with working out a true philosophy. To the degree that it is true, a philosophy is necessarily compatible with Christianity, open to Christianity, utilizable by Christianity and by theology; its content will be able to partially coincide with that of revelation. But a philosophy will never be “Christian” in the formal and rigorous sense. One can, doubtless, speak of Christian philosophers in a purely material sense, to designate philosophies that have been worked out by Christian thinkers. But since the facts demonstrate the latent danger of this usage, it would be better to avoid using an expression that, far from illuminating anything, is a source of confusions and equivocations. (“La IIe journée d’études de la Société Thomiste et la notion de ‘philosophie chrétienne’”, p. 554)

Van Steenberghen made several additional points. Agreeing with Blondel and Sertillanges in that philosophy’s task is to extend itself as far as it can to all of reality, he proposed the Philosophy of Religion in place of Christian philosophy, which should include the sub-discipline ‘Philosophy of Christianity’. He criticized Thomist proponents of Christian philosophy, in particular Gilson, Maritain and Sertillanges, for having “mix[ed] up things important to carefully distinguish” philosophy and theology, and “the personal attitude of the Christian philosopher and the method of philosophy…the psychological coming-to-being of a science and its logical coming-to-being.” (“La IIe journée”, p. 550-1)

4. Positions For Christian Philosophy

a. Etienne Gilson’s Position

Etienne Gilson argued for Christian philosophy’s legitimacy and observable historical reality, and explored particular achievements of Medieval Christian philosophies in depth. Contrary to Henri Gouhier’s critique in his work that “the dossier of the notion of ‘Christian philosophy’ does not appear to present any change, any evolution” (p. 66), Gilson continued to revise his assessment of significant authors during the Debates. Early on in the Debates, bringing up “Saint Augustine’s credo ut intelligam and Saint Anselm’s fides quaerens intellectum,” he considered “these two formulas…the true definition of Christian philosophy” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 48). He would later revise his assessment, narrowing the scope of Christian philosophy primarily to Thomism, construing Augustinianism as reflecting a primacy of faith over reason (Reason and Revelation in the Middle Ages, p. 17-33) and explicitly rejecting the Anselmian fides quaerens intellectum, now seeing “in that formula, an exclusive ambition and limitation, which forbids us from seeing in the definition of the attitude of a Christian philosopher” (“Sens et nature de l’argument de Saint Anselme,” p. 49, note 2).

Gilson grabbed Bréhier’s dilemma by its horns: “I will say that in my view the Christian philosophy he thinks is not interesting at all but does exist, does not exist, whereas the one he deems that it would be interesting but does not exist, does exist” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 52). Historical examination indicates that the Catholic magisterium (in Christianity and Philosophy, Gilson extends his purview to Reformed and Lutheran positions) addresses philosophy in a more complex manner than Bréhier’s simplistic interpretation, so that there never has been a philosophy simply dictated by a religious magisterium. Whether Christianity has in fact made any positive contributions to philosophy remains an open question requiring thorough historical study, which directed Gilson to the existence of Christian philosophies, particularly in the Middle Ages. “What I seek in the notion of Christian philosophy is therefore a conceptual translation of what I believe to be a historically observable object: philosophy in its Christian state” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 73).

He also criticized Neo-Scholastic opponents of Christian philosophy for unnecessarily “adopt[ing] the position of their opponents,” but also for assuming that

[i]n Thomism alone we have a system in which philosophic conclusions are deduced from purely rational premises….Philosophy, doubtless, is subordinate to theology, but, as philosophy, it depends on nothing but its own proper method; based on human reason, owing all of its truth to the self-evidence of its principles and the accuracy of its deduction, it reaches an accord spontaneously and without having to deviate in any way from its own proper path. (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, p. 6)

Any relation between philosophy and Christianity, however, becomes merely fortuitous and extrinsic. “Once reason, as regards its exercise, has been divorced from faith, all intrinsic relation between Christianity and philosophy becomes a contradiction” (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, p. 7). What the Neo-Thomists had forgotten was that “faith and reason are rooted in the unity of the concrete subject.” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 45-6)

Gilson also criticized another position, “philosophy of the concrete,” rightly identifying this with Bergson and wrongly with Blondel. In his view (and Maritain’s, who would make similar criticisms) these philosophies bore strong affinities with Augustinian positions and were favorable to Christian philosophy, but as they were hostile to conceptual articulation, they were liable to stray into theology or apologetics. He also argues against a plausibly Blondelian position: “[a] philosophy open to the supernatural would certainly be compatible with Christianity, but it would not necessarily be a Christian philosophy.”

In order to defend the notion of Christian philosophy, simply noting the existence of philosophies in which Christianity had made some contribution was not sufficient, and Gilson was particularly concerned to clarify Christian philosophy’s nature, providing several definitions of Christian philosophy:

I call Christian every philosophy which, although keeping the two orders formally distinct, nevertheless considers the Christian revelation as an indispensable auxiliary to reason….[T]he concept does not correspond to any simple essence susceptible of abstract definition; but corresponds much rather to a concrete historical reality as something calling for description….[It] includes in its extension all those philosophical systems which were in fact what they were because a Christian religion existed and because they were ready to submit to its influence. (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, p. 37)

If philosophical systems exist, purely rational in their principles and in their methods, whose existence is not explained without the existence of the Christian religion, the philosophies that they define merit the name of Christian philosophies. This notion does not correspond to a concept of a pure essence, that of the philosopher or that of the Christian, but to the possibility of a complex historical reality: that of a revelation generative of reason. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 39)

If there have been philosophies, i.e., systems of rational truths, whose existence cannot be explained historically without taking account of Christianity’s existence, these philosophies should bear the name of Christian philosophies…. For the relation between both concepts to be intrinsic, it is not enough that a philosophy be compatible with Christianity; it is necessary that Christianity have played an active role in the very establishment of that philosophy. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 46)

He also characterized the range, objects, and condition of Christian philosophy:

[T]he content of Christian philosophy is that body of rational truths discovered, explored, or simply safeguarded, thanks to the help that reason receives from revelation (The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, p. 35)

[T]he essential domain of Christian philosophy corresponds exactly to the limits of natural theology, but accidentally, it exerts an influence on almost the whole of philosophy (Christianity and Philosophy, p. 131)

[E]very Christian philosophy will be traversed, impregnated, nourished by Christianity as by a blood that circulates in it, or rather, like a life that animates it. One will never be able to say that here the philosophical ends and the Christian begins; it will be integrally Christian and integrally philosophical or it will not be. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 46)

Gilson’s position made three additional contributions to understanding the nature and the problem of Christian philosophy. First, he repeatedly stresses that an aspect central to the problem of Christian philosophy was the problem of the relations between faith and reason. Second, he specifies that in the use of their reason and in the course of their philosophical activity, past Christian philosophers drew upon resources offered them by the Christian faith and revelation. One way this took place was by ideas, e.g. those of creation ex nihilo, of God as being, of personality, derived originally from the non-rational religious source, then appropriated by Christian (as well as Jewish and Muslim) thinkers, who fruitfully brought them into their philosophical activity and systems. Christian philosophy represents the philosophical activity of reason working on, and bringing rationality to data derived originally from non-rational religious sources.

[O]nce this philosopher is also a Christian, his reason’s exercise will be that of a Christian’s reason, i.e., not a reason of a different type than that of non-Christian philosophers, but a reason that labors under different conditions….[I]t is true that his reason is that of a subject in which there is something non-rational, his religious faith….I ask especially whether the philosophical life is not precisely a constant effort to bring what is irrational in us to the state of rationality….What is peculiar to the Christian is being convinced of the rational fertility of his faith and being sure that this fertility is inexhaustible. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 47)

Third, he redirects focus from abstract ways of framing this problem towards concrete philosophizing human subjects, in whom faith and reason coexist, and who both engage in and are formed by philosophy and Christianity. Gilson guardedly accepts the Augustinian position:

He knows that faith is faith and reason is reason, but he adds that a man’s faith and a man’s reason are not two uncoordinated accidents of the same substance. In his view, the real is the man himself, a profound unity, not dissociable into juxtaposed elements as fragments of a mosaic would be, a unity in which nature and grace, reason and faith, cannot function each one on its own, like in a mechanism whose pieces would have been purchased at the store as separate parts. If therefore a Christian man philosophizes, and if he expresses himself truly in his philosophy, this cannot fail to be a Christian philosophy. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 45)

Gilson argues that this correctly reflects “the real unity of the elements of the concrete in the subject where they are realized….If there were a faith and a reason in us, whose being was radically distinct from that of a thinking substance to which they belong, we could not say of any of us that he was a man” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 45-6).

b. Jacques Maritain’s Position

Maritain regarded his own position as a “doctrinal’ (that is, strictly philosophical) complement to Gilson’s historically derived position. Like Gilson, he criticized rationalist and neo-Scholastic opponents of Christian philosophy, but also articulated fuller criticisms of Blondel (An Essay on Christian Philosophy, p. 7-11, 55-61, Science and Wisdom, p. 82-86). He agreed with Blondel on the mistake of Christian thinkers calling for and generating a “separated philosophy,” which he regarded as “completely contrary to the spirit of Thomism” (Essay, p. 8), but saw three main flaws in Blondel’s position. First, he rightly notes the errors in Blondel’s own critique based on reductive misinterpretations of Gilson’s position. Second, he charges Blondel with a lack of clarity, blurring lines between philosophy and theology, thus

transfer[ring] to the heart of a philosophy what holds true of an apologetics…apologetics, by its own nature and essence presupposes the solicitations of grace and the operations of the heart and will on the part of the one who hears, and the light of faith already possessed on the part of the one who speaks; philosophy by its nature and essence exacts…only reason in the one who searches. (Essay, p. 9)

Third, admitting the “insufficiency of philosophy,” Maritain rejects Blondel’s call for and project of “philosophy of insufficiency,” making charges similar to Gilson’s, that by critiquing conceptualism, Blondel rejects concepts and objective knowledge.

Maritain’s most important contribution was to frame the useful distinction between the nature and the state of philosophy:

[W]e must distinguish between the nature of philosophy, or what it is in itself, and the state in which it exists in real fact, historically, in the human subject, and which pertains to its concrete conditions of existence and exercise. (Essay, p. 11-2)

In its nature or essence, philosophy is “intrinsically a natural and rational form of knowledge” (Essay, p. 14), entirely independent from faith. As a form of knowledge, philosophy is specified by its object(s): “within the realm of the real, created and uncreated…a whole class of objects which are of their nature attainable through the natural faculties of the human mind” (Essay, p. 14). In its nature, however, philosophy is

a pure abstract essence. It is all too easy a matter to endow such an abstraction with reality, to clothe it as such with a concrete existence. An ideological monster results; such, in my opinion, occurred in the case both of the rationalists and the neo-Thomists whom Mr. Gilson has called to task (Essay, p. 14).

In its essence, philosophy is neither Christian nor non-Christian. Turning to concrete states in which philosophy actually exists, it becomes possible for a philosopher to be a Christian and for his or her philosophy to be a Christian philosophy. On this basis, Maritain supplies several characterizations of Christian philosophy. From the start, he frames it as not “a simple essence, but a complex: an essence grasped in a certain state” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 67), later adding: “under conditions of performance, of existence and of life, for or against which one is in fact obliged to make a choice” (Science and Wisdom, p. 81). He clarifies:

Christian philosophy is not a determinate body of truths, although, in my opinion, the doctrine of St. Thomas exemplifies its amplest and purest form. Christian philosophy is philosophy itself in so far as it is situated in those utterly distinctive conditions of existence and exercise into which Christianity has ushered the thinking subject, and as a result of which philosophy perceives certain objects and validly demonstrates certain propositions, which in any other circumstances would to a greater or lesser extent elude it. (Essay, p. 30)

Maritain distinguishes two main ways in which Christianity aids the activity of philosophy in concrete states: objective contributions and subjective reinforcements. Christianity makes objective contributions by supplying philosophy with data and ideas. Some of these “belong within the field of philosophy, but….philosophers failed to recognize [them] explicitly” (Essay, p. 18), e.g. the ideas of creation or of sin. Others are “objective data which philosophy knew well but which it approached with much hesitancy and which…was corroborated by revelation” (Essay, p. 21). Even in cases of mysteries of the Christian faith, philosophy develops further, as an instrument of theology it “learn[s] many things whole being thus led along paths which are not its own” (Essay, p. 22). It also has its field of inquiry, its possible objects of study, expanded, as happened with “speculation on the dogmas of the Trinity and the Incarnation,” productive of “an awareness of the metaphysical problem of the person” (Essay, p. 23).

Subjective reinforcements are the ways in which Christian faith and practice concretely aid the philosophical activity of the human person by putting them in a better condition to do philosophy. Though strictly speaking these are numberless, Maritain identifies several subjective reinforcements bearing on philosophy as a habitus, which attains a better use when set in “synergy and vital solidarity, this dynamic continuity of habitus” with theology (Essay, p. 27). Divine grace also removes or ameliorates impediments to philosophizing well, so that “the more the philosopher remains faithful to grace, the more easily will he free himself of manifold futilities and opacities.” (Essay, p. 28)

c. Maurice Blondel’s Position

Blondel, universally acknowledged by French commentators as the third main proponent of Christian philosophy, developed a complex position intimately connected with previous and later works, and resisting brief summarization. Accordingly, only four main components of his position are addressed here: his critique of rationalists and Neo-Scholastics, his critique of Gilson, the philosophy of insufficiency, history and the problem of the supernatural, and the stages of Christian philosophy.

Since his early works (cf. the Letter on Apologetics), Blondel had criticized the “separated philosophy” of certain Neo-Scholastics for ignoring the problematic imposed on philosophy by the “religious problem” (a meta-philosophical requirement for philosophy to fully take Christianity into account without thereby rationalizing it). By their care to exclude anything explicitly Christian from their philosophizing while still desiring to generate philosophy substantially in agreement with Christian theology, Neo-Scholastic philosophy lapsed into a philosophically sterile “concordism” in which philosophy and Christianity are only extrinsically related to each other, but philosophical doctrines are nevertheless judged correct or incorrect by their agreement with dogma. Blondel also took on Bréhier directly, charging him with relying on his own “dogmatism imposing itself by authority” (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 601), characterized by a reductive and rigid conception of reason and straw-man caricatures of Christian thinkers Bréhier claimed to rationally critique. In this way, “dogmatic rationalism becomes irrational and seems to mutilate history just as much as philosophical speculation itself” (“Y-a-t’il”, p. 600). In particular, Bréhier’s two criticisms of Blondel turn out not only to be untrue, but also mutually inconsistent.

At much greater length and with greater severity, Blondel consistently criticized Gilson’s (and by implication, Maritain’s) position. Though incorrect (and uncharitable) in ascribing these to Gilson, Blondel’s identification and criticism of several errors in handling the problem of Christian philosophy nevertheless retain their philosophical merit. He diagnosed two main (meta-)philosophical mistakes: conceptualism and historicism. Conceptualism maintains

philosophical doctrines, as different as they may be, ultimately aim at sealing themselves off in closed, sufficient, and exclusive systems; these systems organize themselves with and terminate in concepts, and all that does not succeed in being raised into concepts repulses philosophy. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p.87-8)

This reduces philosophy to an abstract, static construction of concepts, hampering philosophy from engaging its full range of objects, obscuring that

this is precisely what is in question: can it not be philosophical, is it not “conceivable”, is it not even normal, that philosophy opens ulterior perspectives…orients and stimulates spiritual life’s dynamism by posing inevitable problems whose complete solution it does not provide, even though it serves to not allow them to be misunderstood nor falsely resolved? (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 88)

What Blondel terms “historicism” reflects attempts to resolve the problem of Christian philosophy through direct appeal to the discipline of history (or history of philosophy). This introduces a dilemma, however, “doubly compromising both to Philosophy and to the Christian Revelation”:

[I]f history as an intermediary, provides data taken from Christianity in a mixture of public facts or of private experiences to the laboratory of philosophical reflection, it is by forcibly stripping the data of their supernatural originality; it accepts them, puts them into its mill, experiments on them in its own natural and rational activity. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 89)

Inversely, by wanting to integrate dogmas, ideas, ascetic practices, mystical experiences coming to it from outside within itself, philosophy that would not have preliminarily opened in itself this empty space of which we spoke, by its very care not to alter the supernatural character of Christian data, introduces a foreign body into its flesh, a packet of incurably wounding spines. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 89)

His reference to the “empty space” leads into Blondel’s positive conception of Christian philosophy, which will be in part “an open philosophy…recogniz[ing] its limits by being ready to accept ulterior data” (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 90). This will be a philosophy of insufficiency, i.e., philosophy that thematizes philosophy’s own insufficiency to fully comprehend, rationally articulate, and systematize its own objects, the ranges of realities to which it extends, and the human subject engaged in philosophizing. It will also acknowledge that philosophy’s own intrinsic requirement of autonomy culminates in philosophy freely allowing itself to be further determined, guided and shaped by something transcending philosophy. Against conceptualism, Blondel proposes another possibility:

must philosophy end up, whatever the level of its development may be, in recognizing how it is normally incomplete, how it opens in itself and before itself an empty space prepared not only for its own ulterior discoveries and on its own ground, but for illuminations and contributions whose real origin it is not and cannot become?…[I]t is this second thesis, philosophically definable and supportable, i.e. without proceeding from a revelation, that is alone in spontaneous and deep agreement with Christianity. Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 90)

He expands the metaphor, employing similar terminology, e.g.:

[a] gap coming from above (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 91)

[the] interior open space or the silence of the soul (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 91)

infinitesimal and real fissures, ‘holes’ that require being filled and which admit consequently the presence or even the need of another reality, of a heterogeneous and complementary datum. (“Le problème de la philosophie catholique,” p. 43)

These spaces occur throughout the fabric of philosophical thought. There are “relations of emptiness and fullness where two incommensurable orders unfold themselves,” (Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne, p. 147) within the same concrete human subject. These spaces are not simply philosophical voids:

[W]e do not remain in the presence of a black hole, of an ocean for which neither ship nor sail would seem possible. The empty space that we spoke of earlier is not a chimerical fiction, projection of restlessness, sickness of the soul. It has…contours to discern, a reason for being to meditate on and to render rationally admissible, an attractive and imperious character. (Bul. Soc fr. Phil., p. 90)

Blondel’s attitude towards history and Christian philosophy is considerably more complex than a simple rejection. From within the perspective generated and secured by a philosophy of insufficiency, appeal to history and reinterpretation of historical examples of Christian philosophy becomes legitimate. History in fact displays a “chronic condition” in which philosophy and Christianity generate “incessant antagonisms or the renewed efforts of compenetration…throughout the ages.” This condition “possesses an intelligible signification”, and it is “philosophy’s role to seek out its causes and to discern its enduring reasons.” (“Le problème,” p. 14) In modernity and through modern thought, the most fundamental aspect of the problem of Christian philosophy come to light. Previous, ultimately unsuccessful, attempts at Christian philosophies have made “the very conception of philosophy evolve….preparing discernment of what remains incommensurable between the rational order and the supernatural order.” (“Le problème,” p. 17) in the end

bringing the always looming crisis between rational autonomy and Christian demands to a vital point that historical, exegetical, and apologetic considerations do not reach, insofar as they appear in isolation without the preliminary question being raised, the question whose precise meaning, normal character, and essential scope we have just tried to exhibit. (“Le problème ,” p. 18-9)

This central question is the “problem of the supernatural” and Christian philosophy has to self-consciously grapple with, conceptualize, and bring about a condition involving:

[n]either dependence nor independence nor simple juxtaposition of the rational order and the Christian order; but a type of heterogeneity in compenetration and of symbiosis in the very incommensurability. (Le problème, p. 145)

In Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne (cf. also “Pour une philosophie intégrale”, p. 57-62), Blondel explicitly construed Christian philosophy as a three-stage set of projects correlated to several states or conditions of human being. Among these is a “a state of nature that actually could subsist, but which also actually has never existed for humanity in the historical and concrete order,” (Le problème, p. 25) i.e. actually an abstraction. The others include those of “original justice,” and of “decay,” the “transnatural state,” and the state in which “a person is introduced into the supernatural order.” (Le problème, p. 25-27)

Each state is a possible object of study for philosophy. Corresponding to the state of nature, “essential philosophy” (that is, philosophy of insufficiency) systematically examines necessary and possible conditions and structures of human thought and action. At this stage, philosophy becomes critically aware of its own insufficiencies, and human reason is brought to recognition, opening, and orientation towards the “empty space” but not yet to determinately entering it.

The second stage, in which philosophy enters the opened space seeking the supernatural, involves a second philosophical project: “a sort of mixed philosophy, a philosophy of the possible relations…between essential possibilities or necessities and realizable contingents.” (Le problème, p. 167). In the third philosophical project, philosophy engages what Christianity teaches to be humanity’s and all other created being’s real condition, becoming reoriented and expanded in the process. At this stage, it becomes possible “to study the repercussions in natural man of the different states – transnatural, supernatural or rebel – that awaken in consciousness and the will data or reactions other than those of a pure state of nature.” (Le problème, p. 171)

d. Gabriel Marcel’s Position

In his position on Christian philosophy, Marcel harmonized the positions, believed incompatible by their authors, of Gilson and Maritain on one side, and Blondel on the other. He also made enough original contributions of his own to justify interpreting his position as a fourth main position for Christian philosophy. One of these contributions was raising an additional problem for rationalist or neo-Scholastic opponents of Christian philosophy:

If it was admitted that Christianity has had no positive influence on philosophical development, this would entail saying that it has never actually been able to be thought – for there is no thought worthy of that name that does not contribute to transforming all the other thoughts….To say that Christianity has never been thought is to let it be understood that it is not thinkable. (“A propos de L’esprit de la Philosophie médiévale par M. E. Gilson,” p. 309)

While praising Gilson’s The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy, Marcel argued, in terms similar to Blondel’s, that

[t]he contribution here is a certain datum – a revealed datum – whose signification, whose value is absolutely transcendent to any experience susceptible of being constituted on purely human bases. There is the paradox, the scandal, if you like. I would be disposed for my part, to think that there is Christian philosophy only there where this paradox, this scandal is not only admitted or even accepted, but embraced with a passionate and unrestricted gratitude. From the moment on when, to the contrary, philosophy seeks by some procedure to attenuate this scandal, to mask the paradox, to reabsorb the revealed datum in a dialectic of pure reason or mind, to this precise degree it ceases to be a Christian philosophy (“A propos”, p. 311-2)

The paradox or scandal Marcel regards as most central to Christian philosophy is the Incarnation, which bears important implications for philosophy and reason itself.

Perhaps it would not be abusive to claim that the essence of such a philosophy is a meditation on that datum’s implications and consequences of every order, not only unpredictable but contrary to reason’s superficial demands from the very start wrongly posing themselves as inviolable. But, the essential function of metaphysical reflection will consist in critiquing these demands in the name of higher demands, and consequently in the name of a superior reason that faith in the Incarnation puts precisely in the condition of becoming fully conscious of itself. (“A propos”, p. 312)

He adds that “the central light residing in the Incarnation radiates in reality through all of the regions of metaphysics” (“A propos”, p. 312), generating the historical examples of Christian philosophy Gilson studied and identified in his works. Christian philosophy, as Marcel envisioned it, has the task not only of noting cases where Christianity has exerted a generative effect on philosophy, but also of investigating how this is possible. This, in turn, requires that “our reason – a created reason ordered to the intelligence of created nature – must, in deepening itself, recognize what in it exceeds the domain of adequacy to itself” (“A propos”, p. 1305).

e. Other Positions Reconciling the Gilson-Maritain and Blondel Positions

Although numerous philosophers have accepted the verdict of fundamental incompatibility between the Gilson-Maritain and Blondel positions, many participants in and commentators on the debates early on saw not only compatibility but even complementarity between their positions, among them Antonin Sertillanges, Bruno De Solages, Aimé Forest, and Henri De Lubac (all of whom were Thomists). Asserting this involved not only arguing compatibility between the positions on Christian philosophy, but also interpreting Thomism as being compatible with the requirements of Blondel’s non-Thomist philosophy.

De Solages likens Gilson’s, Maritain’s and Blondel’s positions on Christian philosophy to three different paths climbing the same mountain:

None of the three lead to the same peak, for our mountain has three peaks, but it seems to me that the view that one has from each of them marvelously completes the view that one has from the others, and that all three allow one to make for oneself a sufficiently complex and exact idea of this complex reality. (“Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne,” p. 232)

De Lubac, drawing from De Solages and Sertillanges, provides a classic account reconciling Blondel with Gilson and Maritain, as well as noting certain differences between the latter two.

If we believe Maritain and Gilson, their two positions come together, one in treating the problem from the historical point of view and the other. In practice, however, Gilson, who is the better historian, admits a greater influence than Maritain concedes…. [O]nly the third thesis, that of Blondel, establishes a truly intrinsic relationship between rational speculation and supernatural revelation, without, for all that, opening to philosophy the mysterious content of this revelation. (“Retrieving the Tradition: On Christian Philosophy”, p.482-3)

He distinguishes several different distinguishable types of Christian philosophy:

[T]here is another sense in which one can and must speak of a Christian philosophy…a sense no longer historical but metaphysical. It is, then, no longer a matter of a philosophy, or of philosophies, which, in fact, find themselves to be Christian because they have received a Christian contribution…Instead, it is a question of the philosophy, which, to be truly and integrally philosophy, must, in a certain way, be Christian. (“Retrieving the Tradition”, p 486)

The relationship between these types is not one of opposition or exclusion, but one going beyond even compatibility or complementarity to mutual requirement. The Gilson-Maritain position needs to be completed and self-critically secured by the Blondelian one: “[T]o the double recognition of the subjective comforts and the objective contributions which philosophy owes to Christianity, it is indispensable to add the elaboration of a philosophy of insufficiency.” Additionally, “posing the problem of the relationship between supernatural mystery and the reason it fertilizes, leads us to look for another more comprehensive meaning of Christian philosophy.” (“Retrieving the Tradition”, p. 494-5) Blondel’s thought is possible, however, only on the unacknowledged basis of the type of Christian philosophy Gilson and Maritain focused on:

[I]f we speak concretely, psychologically, and historically, we will say that this absolute Christian philosophy presupposes the first kind of Christian philosophy, which is completely contingent. We add that it presupposes this contingent Christian philosophy as already established and developed for enough time to have profoundly penetrated the understanding and to have laid bare the secret law. (“Retrieving the Tradition,” p. 488)

5. References and Further Reading

This selective bibliography provides reference to only a portion of the literature either from or about the debates about Christian philosophy, positions developed, and issues involved. For more extensive bibliographies, cf. Bernard Badoux, O.F.M., “Quaestio de philosophia christiana,” Antonianum, vol. 11, p. 487-552; and Luigi Bogliolo. La Filosophia Cristiana: Il problema, la storia, la struttura (Rome: Libreria Editrice Vaticana. 1986). All translations from the French, unless otherwise noted in the bibliography, are the author’s.

a. Literature from the 1930s Christian Philosophy Debates

This list includes two types of literature: 1) books, articles, and conference reports directly part of the debates; 2) books, articles, and conference reports subsequent to the debates in which the positions of these participants are further developed. Many other documents not listed here, of lesser importance or centrality, also form part of the debates.

“La notion de philosophie chrétienne”, Session of 21 March 1931, Bulletin de la Société française de Philosophie, v. 31. Includes:
- Main Presentation by Etienne Gilson
  Presentations by Emile Bréhier, Jacques Maritain, Léon Brunschvicg, Edouard Le Roy, and Raymond Lenoir
  Discussion between Gilson, Bréhier, and Brunschvicg
  Letters from Maurice Blondel and Jacques Chevalier
La philosophie chétienne: Juvisy, 11 Septembre 1933 (Account of the 2nd Day of Studies of the Société Thomiste). (Paris: Cerf. 1933) Includes:
- M.D. Chenu, O. P. “Allocation d’Ouverture”
  Aimé Forest, “Le problème historique de la philosophie chrétienne”
  A.R. Motte, “Vers une solutions doctrinale du problème de la philosophie chrétienne”
  Discussion by numerous members of the Société Thomiste, including substantive presentations made by Festugière, Etienne Gilson, Pierre Mandonnet, Antonin Sertillanges, Daniel Feuling, Masnovo, Cochet,
  Appendix: Correspondence from Jacques Maritain, M.E. Baudin, Roland-Gosselin, O.P. , M.G. Rabeau
Blondel, Maurice. “Autonomie normale et connexion réelle de la philosophie et de la religion,” in Library of the 10th international congress of philosophy (Amsterdam 1948). Amsterdam : North Holland, 1948, vol. 1, p. 207-208
Blondel, Maurice. “La philosophie ouverte” in Henri Bergson: Essais et témoignages inédits. Albert Béguin, Pierre Thévenaz, eds. (Neuchâtel: Baconnière. 1941), p. 73-90
Blondel, Maurice. “Le centre de perspective où il faut se placer pour que la philosophie catholique soit concevable.” Archivio di filosofia, vol. 2, no. 2, p. 3-15 (1932).
Blondel, Maurice. “Le devoir intégral de la philosophie” in Actas del primer congreso nacional de filosofia (1949). (Mendoza, Argentina: Univ. Nacional de Cuyo. 1950), vol. 2, p. 884-889.
Blondel, Maurice. Le problème de la philosophie catholique (Paris: Bloud & Gay. 1932)
Blondel, Maurice. “Le problème de la philosophie catholique: Seance of 26 Nov 1932”, Les Etudes Philosophiques vol. 7, no. 1.
- Includes letters and discussion by: Enrico Castelli, Jean Delvolvé, Henri Gouhier, Joseph Maréchal, S.J, Jacques Palliard, Gaston Berger
Blondel, Maurice. “Office du philosophe”, Revue Thomiste, vol. 19, p. 587-592 (1936).
Blondel, Maurice. “Philosophie et Christianisme,” Vie Intellectuelle, 25 Jan 1940, p. 96-105.
Blondel, Maurice. “Pour la philosophie integrale”, Revue néoscholastique de Philosophie, vol. 37, p. 49-64. (1934).
Blondel, Maurice. “Réponse irénique à des méprises : Comment comprendre et justifier l’accès à la vie surnaturelle?”Giornale di metafisica vol. 3, p. 44-48 (1948).
Blondel, Maurice. (under the pseudonym “X”), “Une philosophie chrétienne est-elle rationallement concevable? Est-elle historiquement réalisé? Etat actuel de ce debat”, Revue des Questions Historiques, vol. 116, p. 389-393 (1932).
Blondel, Maurice. “Y-a-t’il une philosophie chrétienne?”, Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale, vol 38, no.4 (1931).
Borne, Etienne. “D’une ‘Philosophie Chrétienne’ qui serait philosophique,” Esprit, November 1932, p. 335-340.
Bréhier, Emile. “Comment je comprends l’histoire de la philosophie,” Etudes Philosophiques, p. 105-13 (1947). Reprinted in Etudes de philosophie antique (Paris: PUF. 1955), p. 1-9.
Bréhier, Emile. “Y-a-t’il une philosophie chrétienne?” Revue de Métaphysique et de la Morale, vol. 38 no. 2, p. 133-162 (1931).
Brunschvicg, Léon. “De la vraie et fausse conversion,” (parts 1-2) Revue de Métaphysique et de la Morale., vol. 38 no. 1, p. 29-60, n. 2, p. 187-235. All parts later published as De la vraie et de la fausse conversion: suivi de La querelle de l’athéisme (Paris: Presses Universitaires de France. 1951)
Brunschvicg, Léon. “Religion et Philosophie”, Revue de la Métaphysique et de la Morale, vol. 42, no. 1, p. 1-13. (1935).
Brunschvicg, Léon. La Raison et la Religion (Paris: Felix Alcan. 1939)
Chestov, Léon. “Athènes et Jérusalem (Concupiscentia irresistibilis)”, Revue Philosophique, vol. 120, p. 305-349. Later becomes part 3 of Athènes et Jérusalem (Paris. 1937)
Gilson, Etienne. “Autour de la philosophie chrétienne. La spécificité de l’ordre philosophique”, La Vie Intellectuelle, vol. 21, no. 3, p. 404-424. Translated as “Concerning Christian Philosophy: the Distinctiveness of the Philosophic Order” in Philosophy and history: Essays Presented to Ernst Cassirer (Oxford: Clarendon Press. 1936), p. 61-76.
Gilson, Etienne. Christianisme et Philosophie. (Paris: Vrin. 1936). Translated as Christianity and Philosophy by Ralph MacDonald, C.S.B. (New York: Sheet & Ward. 1939).
Gilson, Etienne. Elements of Christian Philosophy. (Garden City, N.Y.: Doubleday: 1960).
Gilson, Etienne. History of Christian philosophy in the Middle Ages (New York: Random House, 1955).
Gilson, Etienne. “La possibilité philosophique de la philosophie chrétienne”, Revue des sciences religieuses, vol. 32.
Gilson, Etienne. Introduction à la Philosophie Chrétienne. (Paris: Vrin, 1960) translated by Armand Maurer as Christian Philosophy: An Introduction (Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies. 1993).
Gilson, Etienne. L’esprit de la Philosophie médiévale. Translated by A.H.C. Downes as The Spirit of Medieval Philosophy (Gifford Lectures 1931-1932) (New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons. 1936).
Gilson, Etienne. “Le christianisme et la tradition philosophique,” Sciences Philosophiques et Théologiques, vol. 20, p. 249-266. (1941).
Gilson, Etienne. Le Philosophe et la Théologie (Paris: Fayard. 1960) Translated by Cecile Gilson as The Philosopher and Theology (New York: Random House. 1962).
Gilson, Etienne. Reason and Revelation in the Middle Ages. (New York: Scribner’s. 1938)
Gilson, Etienne. The Unity of Philosophical Experience. (New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1937)
Gilson, Etienne. “What is Christian Philosophy?” in A Gilson Reader. Anton Pegis, ed. (Garden City, NY: Hanover House, 1957) p. 177-191
de Lubac, Henri. “Sur la philosophie chretienne, reflexions a la suite d’un debat”, Nouvelle Revue Théologique, vol. 63, no. 3, p. 125-53, English translation: “Retrieving the Tradition: On Christian Philosophy”, Communio, vol. 19, p. 478-506 (1992).
Marc, André, S.J. “La philosophie chrétienne et la théologie”, La Vie Intellectuelle, vol. 24, p. 21-27(1933).
Marcel, Gabriel. “A propos de L’esprit de la Philosophie médiévale par M. E. Gilson”, Nouvelle Revue des Jeunes, vol. 4, no. 3, p. 308-315 (1932).
Marcel, Gabriel. “A propos de L’esprit de la Philosophie médiévale par M. E. Gilson”, Nouvelle Revue des Jeunes, vol. 4, no. 12, p. 1302-1309 (1932).
Marcel, Gabriel. “Position du mystère ontologique et ses approches concrètes”, Les Etudes Philosophiques, vol. 7, no. 3, p. 95-102 (with responses by Blondel and Bréhier). Later translated in Being and Having: An Existentialist Diary. Trans. Katherine Farrer. (New York: Harper. 1965) p.116-121.
Maritain, Jacques. Approches sans entraves. (Paris: Fayard.1973). Translated as Untrammeled Approaches (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press. 1997).
Maritain, Jacques. “A propos de la philosophie chrétienne,” translated as “About Christian Philosophy,” in The Human Person and the World of Values Balduin Schwarz, ed. (New York: Fordham University. Press. 1960), p. 1-11.
Maritain, Jacques. “De la notion de philosophie chrétienne”, Revue néo-scolastique de philosophie, vol. 36, p. 153-86. (1932).
Maritain, Jacques. Essai sur la philosophie chrétienne Translated as An Essay on Christian Philosophy, by Edward Flannery (New York: Philosophical Library. 1955)
Maritain, Jacques. Raison et raisons, essais détachés (Paris: Egloff. 1948) later expanded and translated as The Range of Reason (New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons. 1952).
Maritain, Jacques. Science et sagesse, suivi d’éclaircissements sur ses frontières et son objet (Paris: Téqui. 1935). translated by Bernard Wall as Science and Wisdom (New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1940)
Noël, Léon. “La notion de philosophie chrétienne,” Revue néoscholastique de Philosophie, vol. 37 (1934).
Sertillanges, Antonin D., O.P.“De la philosophie chrétienne”, La Vie Intellectuelle, vol. 24. no. 1, p. 9-20 (1933).
Sertillanges, Antonin D., O.P. “L’apport philosophique du Christianisme d’après M. Etienne Gilson”, La Vie Intellectuelle, vol. 14, p. 386-402 (1932).
Sertillanges, Antonin D., O.P. Le Christianisme et les philosophies (Paris: Aubier. 1939)
de Solages, Bruno. “Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne,” La Vie Intellectuelle, vol. 25, no. 3, p. 215-228 (1933).
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. “Etienne Gilson: historian de la pensée médievale”, Revue Philosophique de Louvain, vol. 77, p. 487-508 (1979).
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. Etudes philosophiques (Longueuil, Canada: Le Préambule. 1980)
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. Histoire de la philosophie; période chrétienne. (Paris: Nauwelaerts, 1964)
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. Introduction à l’étude de la philosophie médiévale (Paris, Béatrice-Nauwelaerts. 1974)
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. “L’interpretation de la pensée médievale au cours du siècle écoulé,” Revue Philosophique de Louvain, vol. 49, p. 108-19 (1951).
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. “La IIe journée d’études de la Société Thomiste et la notion de ‘philosophie chrétienne’”, Revue néoscholastique de Philosophie, vol. 35, p. 539-554 (1933).
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. “La Philosophie de S. Augustin d’après les travaux du centenaire”, Revue Néoscholastique, vol. 35, pp. 106-127, 231-281 (1933).
Van Steenberghen, Fernand. “Philosophie et christianisme: Épilogue d’un débat ancien”, Revue Philosophique de Louvain, v. 86 (1988).

b. Selected Literature from 1940s and 50s Reformed Protestant Discussions about Christian Philosophy

Le problème de la philosophie chrétienne (Paris: P.U.F. 1949), includes :
- Jean Boisset, “Introduction”
  Edmond Rochedieu, “Philosophie chrétienne et vérité théologique”
  Paul Ricouer, “Le renouvellement du problème de la philosophie chrétienne par les philosophies de l’existence”
  Paul Arbouse-Bastide, “Les voies de la raison et la voie de l’amour”
  Jacques Bois, “Unité du christianisme et de la philosophie”
  Maurice Neeser, “La théologie chrétienne peut-elle prétendre à une place dans l’organisme des sciences humaines?”
Bois, Jacques. “Philosophie et Religion” (1st part), Études Théologiques et religieuses, Nov. (1933).
Bois, Jacques. “Philosophie et Religion” (2nd part), Études Théologiques et religieuses, vol. 9, no. 1, p. 35-49 (1934).
Guérin, Pierre. “A propos de la philosophie chrétienne”, Revue d’Histoire et de Philosophie religeuses, p. 210-242. (1935)
Guérin, Pierre. “La condition du philosophe chrétien”, Revue de Théologie et de Philosophie, vol. 37, p. 65-78. (1949).
Mehl, Roger. “Die Philosophie vor der Théologie,” Theologische Literaturzeitung, no. 10, p. 586-90 (1950).
Mehl, Roger. Le condition du philosophe chrétien. (Paris: Niestlé. 1947) Translated as The Condition of the Christian philosopher by Eva Kushner (Philadelphia: Fortress Press. 1963).
Reymond, A. “Philosophie et théologie dialectique”, Revue de Théologie et de Philosophie, v. 33, p. 255-281. Later published in Philosophie spiritualiste.
Ricouer, Paul. “Le renouvellement du problème de la philosophie chrétienne par les philosophiques de l’existence,” in Les Problèmes de la Pensèe Chrétienne, vol. 4: Le Problème de la Philosophie Chrétienne (Paris: 1949), p. 43-67.
Ricouer, Paul. “l’Homme de Science at l’Homme de Foi”, in Récherches et Débats: Pensée Scientifique et foi chrétienne, vol. 4 (1953)
Souriau, Michel, “Qu’est-ce qu’une philosophie chrétienne?” Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale, vol 39, no. 3, p. 353-385 (1932)
Thévenaz, Pierre. “De la philosophie divine à la philosophie chrétienne,” Revue de Théologie et de Philosophie, vol. 1, p. 4-20 (1951).
Thévenaz, Pierre. “Dieu des philosophes et Dieu des chrétiens,” Revue de Théologie et de Philosophie, v. 6, p. 203-15 (1954).

c. Selected Literature about the 1930s Christian Philosophy Debates and Positions on the Issue of Christian Philosophy

d’Andrea, Thomas, “Rethinking the Christian Philosophy Debate: An Old Puzzle and Some New Points of Orientation,” Acta Philosophica, vol. 1, no. 2, p. 191-214.
Badoux, Bernard, O.F.M., “Quaestio de philosophia christiana,” Antonianum, vol. 11, p. 487-552 (1936).
de Blic, J., S.J., “Quonam sensu recta sit locutio ‘philosophia christiana’?”, Acta Secundi Congressus Thomistici Internationalis, p. 450-453 (1936).
Bremond, André, S.J. “Rationalisme et Religion,” Archives de philosophie, vol. 11, no. 4, p. 1-59 (1934)
Bogliolo, Luigi. Il problema della filosophia cristiana (Brescia: Morcelliana. 1959)
Bogliolo, Luigi. La Filosophia Cristiana: Il problema, la storia, la struttura (Rome: Libreria Editrice Vaticana. 1986)
Chenu, Marie-Domnique. “Les ‘Philosophes’ dans la philosophie chrétienne médievale,” Revue des Sciences philosophiques et théologiques, vol. 27, no. 1, p. 27-40 (1937).
Chenu, Marie-Domnique. “Note pour l’histoire de la notion de philosophie chrétienne,” Revue des Sciences philosophiques et théologiques, vol. 21 no. 2, p. 230-5 (1932).
Chenu, Marie-Domnique. “Ratio superior et inferior. Un cas de philosophie chrétienne,” Laval Théologique et Philosophique, vol. 1 , no. 1, p. 119-23 (1945).
Coreth Emmerich, W. M. Neidl and G. Pfligersdorffer, eds. Christliche Philosophie im katholischen Denken des 19. und 20. Jahrhunderts, v. Neue Ansätze im 19. Jahrhundert (Graz/Wien/Köln: 1987).
Coreth Emmerich, W. M. Neidl and G. Pfligersdorffer, eds. Christliche Philosophie im katholischen Denken des 19. und 20. Jahrhunderts, v. 2: Rückgriff auf scholastisches Erbe. (Graz/Wien/Köln: 1988).
Coreth Emmerich, W. M. Neidl and G. Pfligersdorffer, eds. Christliche Philosophie im katholischen Denken des 19. und 20. Jahrhundert,v. 3: Moderne Strömungen im 20. Jahrhundert (Graz/Wien/Köln: 1990).
Donneaud, Henry, O.P, “Etienne Gilson et Maurice Blondel dans le débat sur la philosophie chrétienne”, Revue Thomiste. vol. 99, p. 497-516
English, Adam C. The Possibility of Christian Philosophy : Maurice Blondel at the Intersection of Theology and Philosophy. (New York : Routledge. 2007)
Forest, Aimé. “Deux historiens de la philosophie”in Philosophe de la chrétienité. (Paris: Cerf. 1949)
Forest, Aimé. “‘La philosophie du Moyen Age’ d’après M. Emile Bréhier”, Revue de Métaphysique et de la Morale (1939).
Floucat, Yves. Métaphysique et religion. Vers une sagesse chrétienne intégrale (Paris: Téqui 1989).
Floucat, Yves. Pour une philosophie chrétienne: élements d’un débat fondamental (Paris: Téqui. 1983)
Gouhier, Henri. “Digression sur la philosophie à propos de la philosophie chrétienne”, Recherches Philosophiques, vol. 3, p. 211-236 (1933).
Gouhier, Henri. Etienne Gilson: Trois Essais: Bergson, La philosophie chrétienne, l’art. (Paris: Vrin. 1993)
Gouhier, Henri. La philosophie et son histoire. (Paris: Vrin. 1947)
Gouhier, Henri. “De l’histoire de la Philosophie à la Philosophie” in Etienne Gilson: Philosophe de la chrétienité. (Paris: Cerf. 1949)
Gouhier, Henri. “Philosophie chrétienne et théologie”, Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’étranger, vol.125, p. 23-65 (1938).
Hayen, André. “Philosophie de conversion – philosophie du converti”, L’ami du Clergé, no. 46, p. 705-12. Translated as “Philosophy of the Converted – Philosophy of Conversion: Blondel and Maritain,” Philosophy Today, vol. 6, no. 2, p. 283-94.
Henrici, Peter. Aufbrüche christlichen Denkens (Einsiedeln: Johannes 1978)
Henrici, Peter. “Der Beitrag christlichen Philosophierens heute”, in Die Philosophie in der modernen Welt. Gedenkschrift Alwin Diemer, ed. U. Hinke-Dürnemann (Frankfurt: Peter Lang. 1988) p. 819-31.
Henrici, Peter. “Der Gott der Philosophen”, Internationale Katholische Zeitschrift Communio, v. 17
Henrici, Peter. “Philosophieren aus dem Glauben: Hundert Jahre nach Aeterni Patris,” Zeitschrift für katholische Theologie, vol. 103, p. 361-73.
Henrici, Peter. “The One Who Went Unnamed: Maurice Blondel in the Encyclical Fides et Ratio,” Communio, vol. 26, p. 609-621.
Copleston, Frederick Charles, S.J. History of Philosophy, vol. 9: Maine De Biran to Sartre (Mahwah, N.J.: Paulist Press. 1975)
Copleston, Frederick Charles, S.J. “The One Who Went Unnamed: Maurice Blondel in the Encyclical Fides et Ratio,” Communio, vol. 26, p. 609-621.
Jordan, Mark D., “The Terms of the Debate over ‘Christian Philosophy,’” Communio: International Catholic Review, vol. 12, p. 293-311.
Livi, Antonio. Blondel, Bréhier, Gilson, Maritain: il problema della filosofia cristiana. (Bolonia: Patron. 1974)
Long, Fiachra. “The Blondel-Gilson Correspondence through Foucault’s Mirror” Philosophy Today, vol. 35, no. 4, p. 351-361.
Maydieu, Jean-Joseph, “Le bilan d’un débat philosophique: réflexions sur la philosophie chrétienne,” Bulletin de Littérature Ecclésiastique, no. 9-10, p. 193-22 (1935).
McInerny, Ralph. Art and Prudence: Studies in the Thought of Jacques Maritain. (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press. 1988)
McInerny, Ralph. “John Paul II and Christian Philosophy,” in John Paul II: Witness to Truth : Proceedings from the Twenty-Third Annual Convention of the Fellowship of Catholic Scholars. Kenneth Whitehead, ed., p. 113-25.
McInerny, Ralph. Praeambula Fidei: Thomism and the God of the Philosophers. (Washington D.C.: Catholic University of America Press. 2006)
McInerny, Ralph. “Reflections on Christian Philosophy,” in One Hundred Years of Thomism: Aeterni Patris and Afterwards. A Symposium Victor B Bresik, C.S.B., ed. (Houston: Center for Thomistic Studies. 1981).
Nédoncelle, Maurice, Existe-t-il une philosophie chrétienne? (Paris: Fayard. 1957), translated as Is There a Christian Philosophy? (Hawthorn Books. 1960)
Owens, Joseph. “Neo-Thomism and Christian Philosophy” in Thomistic Papers, v. 6.
Owens, Joseph. “The Need for Christian Philosophy,”Faith and Philosophy, vol 11, no 2.
Owens, Joseph. Towards a Christian Philosophy. (Washington D.C.: CUA Press. 1990).
Peperzak, Adriaan T. Philosophy Between Faith and Theology: Addresses To Catholic Intellectuals. (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press. 2005)
Peperzak, Adriaan T. Reason In Faith: On the Relevance of Christian Spirituality for Philosophy (New York: Paulist Press. 1999)
Prouvost, Gery. Catholicité de l’intelligence métaphysique : La philosophie dans la foi selon Jacques Maritain (Paris: Tequi. 1991)
Renard, Alex, La Querelle sur la possibilité de la philosophie chrétienne: essai documentaire et critique (Paris: Editions Ecole et College. 1941).
Romeyer, Blaise, “Autour du problème de la philosophie chrétienne: essai critique et positif”, Archives de philosophie, vol. 10, no. 4, p. 1-64 (1934).
Sadler, Gregory B. “St. Anselm’s Fides Quaerens Intellectum as a Model for Christian Philosophy ”, The Saint Anselm Journal, vol. 4, no. 1, p. 32-58.
Secretan, Philibert, ed. La philosophie chrétienne d’inspiration catholique: Constants et controverses, positions actuelles (Fribourg: Academic Press Fribourg. 2006).
Sillem, Edward A., “Perspectives on Christian Philosophy”, The Clergy Review, vol. 46, no. 3, p. 149-65. republished in Philosophy Today, vol. 5, no. 1/4, p. 3-13.
Tilliette, Xavier. “Edith Stein et la philosophie chretienne: A propos d’Etre fini et Etre eternel”, Greganorium, vol. 71, p. 97-113.
Tilliette, Xavier. Le Christ de la philosophie: Prolégomènes à une christologie philosophique. (Paris: Cerf. 1990).
Tilliette, Xavier. “le pere de Lubac et le debat de la philosophie chrétienne,” Etudes Philosophique. 1995, no. 2.
West, Jason L. A. “The Thomistic Debate Concerning the Existence and Nature of Christian Philosophy: Towards a Synthesis,” The Modern Schoolman, vol. 77, p. 49-72.

Author Information

Greg Sadler
Email: greg@reasonio.com
Marist College and ReasonIO
U. S. A.

Epistemic Circularity

Table of Contents

1. Alston on Epistemic Circularity

2. Epistemic Failure

3. Easy Knowledge and the KR Principle

4. Coherence and Reflective Knowledge

5. The Problem of the Criterion

6. Basic Reliability Knowledge

7. Wittgenstein, Entitlement and Practical Rationality

8. Sensitivity

9. Dialectical Ineffectiveness and the Inability to Defeat Defeaters

10. Epistemology and Dialectic

11. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Inconsistent Mathematics

Table of Contents

1. Introduction

a. An Example

2. Background

a. Motivations

b. Perspectives

c. Methods

d. Proofs

3. Geometry

4. Set Theory

5. Arithmetic

6. Analysis

7. Computer Science

8. References and Further Reading

a. Further Reading

b. References

Author Information

Philosophy of Language

Table of Contents

1. Frege, Russell and the Linguistic Turn

a. Referential Theories of Meaning

b. Frege on Sense and Reference

c. Russell

2. Early Analytical Philosophy of Language

a. The Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus

b. The Vienna Circle and the Logical Positivists

c. Tarski’s Theory of Truth

3. Mid-century Revolutions

a. Quine and the Analytic/Synthetic Distinction

b. The Later Wittgenstein

4. Major Areas in the Contemporary Field

a. Truth-Conditional Theories of Meaning

b. Meaning and Use

c. Speech Act Theory and Pragmatics

5. Future Directions and Emerging Debates

6. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Philosophy of Sexuality

Table of Contents

1. Metaphysics of Sexuality

2. Metaphysical Sexual Pessimism

3. Metaphysical Sexual Optimism

4. Moral Evaluations

5. Nonmoral Evaluations

6. The Dangers of Sex

7. Sexual Perversion

8. Sexual Perversion and Morality

9. Aquinas’s Natural Law

10. Nagel’s Secular Philosophy

11. Fetishism

12. Female Sexuality and Natural Law

13. Debates in Sexual Ethics

14. Natural Law vs. Liberal Ethics

15. Consent Is Not Sufficient

16. Consent Is Sufficient

17. What Is “Voluntary”?

18. Conceptual Analysis

19. Sexual Activity vs. “Having Sex”

20. Sexual Activity and Sexual Pleasure

a. Sexual Activity Without Pleasure

21. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Plato (427—347 B.C.E.)

Table of Contents

1. Biography