Compositionality in Language

Compositionality is a concept in the philosophy of language. A symbolic system is compositional if the meaning of every complex expression E in that system depends on, and depends only on, (i) E’s syntactic structure and (ii) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

If a language is compositional, then the meaning of a sentence S in that language cannot depend directly on the context that sentence is used in or the intentions of the speaker who uses it. So, for example, in compositional languages, the meanings of sentences don’t directly depend on

Things said earlier in the conversation
The beliefs or intentions of the person uttering S
Salient objects and events in the environment at the time that S is uttered
The non-semantic character of S’s simple parts, such as their shape or sound

In compositional languages, the meaning of a sentence S directly depends only on the meanings of the words composing S, and the way those words are syntactically related to one another.

Of course, simple expressions in a compositional language might have meanings that depend on the context or on the intentions of their users, as the referent of the English pronoun ‘she’ can depend on who the speaker intends to be referring to. As such, sentences containing expressions such as ‘she’ will indirectly depend on the intentions of their speakers, because the meaning of the sentence depends on the meanings of its simple parts and the meanings of some of those parts depend on the speaker’s intentions.

Several arguments purport to show that not only is natural language compositional, but that it must be, since we could not have the linguistic abilities we in fact do have, unless the languages we speak are compositional. A commitment to compositionality has driven a large amount of research in the philosophy of language and in linguistics, since it appears to be very difficult to provide adequate compositional treatments of commonplace linguistic constructions. On the other hand, some philosophers have argued that natural language is not compositional, or that compositionality induces no substantive restriction on possible theories of meaning.

This article addresses the different ways compositionality has been understood by philosophers and linguists, and surveys the arguments that natural language is, must be, or should be compositional, as well as the arguments that it isn’t or needn’t be.

Interpretations of Compositionality
Arguments for Compositionality
The Dialectical Role of Compositionality in Philosophy
1. Real Meanings
2. Semantic Theories Purportedly at Odds with Compositionality
Challenges to Compositionality
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Interpretations of Compositionality

a. Syntactic Structure

In natural languages (such as English, Cantonese, and Kalaallisut), the smallest meaningful symbols are called “morphemes.” For highly analytic languages such as English, there is a large overlap between morphemes and words: words are largely the smallest meaningful units. English does have a number of morphemes that are not words, however, such as the plural ending –s for nouns, the possessive ending –’s for noun phrases, and the 3^rd person singular ending –s for verbs. These are “bound” morphemes, in that they cannot grammatically occur on their own. In other, more synthetic languages such as Kalaallisut, single words can be made of many meaningful parts. The word atuartariaqalirpuq (“he began to have to study”) contains six morphemes, and can be used by itself as a sentence (example from Bittner 1995).

Morphology is the set of rules governing how morphemes are combined to form words; syntax is the set of rules governing how words are combined to form phrases and, ultimately, sentences. These rules describe (among other things) how smaller parts, the constituents, are put together to form larger units. The syntactic rules that formed an expression can affect its meaning. Consider the expression ‘large horse painting’: it can either mean painting of a large horse or large painting of a horse, depending on whether ‘large’ is modifying ‘horse painting’ or just ‘horse.’

The principal claim regarding compositionality that philosophers have been concerned with is the claim that all actual and possible natural languages are compositional. A natural language is a language that humans learn to speak naturally, as part of their development, as opposed to an artificial language such as computer languages. In this context, the claim that natural languages are compositional amounts to the claim that the meanings of complex (multi-morphemic) expressions are determined by and only by (i) the ways their morphemes are put together by the morphosyntactic rules of the language and (ii) the meanings of those morphemes.

This may seem like a clear statement of a single thesis, but unfortunately there is wide philosophical disagreement concerning (a) what meanings are and (b) how we should understand ‘dependence’ in the statement of compositionality. We turn now to these two issues.

b. Meaning

There are two ways in which there are a wide variety of meanings of ‘meaning.’ First, many different philosophers will use the word ‘meaning’ and understand by it various distinct things. Some will think meanings are conceptual roles; others that they are set-theoretic objects and functions. Second, one and the same philosopher may recognize several types or dimensions of meaning. She may think, for example, that connotations are meanings in one sense, and that denotations are meanings in a different sense. In discussing compositionality, a reasonable stance is to consider all proposed types of meanings as bona fide meanings and therefore understand that there are numerous compositionality theses. For example:

Compositionality of stereotype: the stereotype associated with a complex expression E in a natural language is determined by (and only by) (i) E’s morphosyntactic structure and (ii) the stereotypes associated with E’s morphemes.

Compositionality of semantic features: the semantic features (e.g. [+male] or [+animate], as they attach to ‘he’ and ‘who,’ respectively) of a complex expression E in a natural language is determined by (and only by) (i) E’s morphosyntactic structure and (ii) the semantic features of E’s morphemes.

It goes like this for each possible type or dimension of meaning. The philosophical question is which, if any, of these theses is true. Any argument for or against compositionality should make it clear what conception of meaning it takes to be or not to be compositional. It is quite possible that there are several legitimate conceptions of meaning, each deserving the name ‘meaning,’ where based on some of those conceptions, natural languages are compositional, and based on other of those conceptions, they are not.

The question that has perhaps most concerned philosophers interested in compositionality is whether the truth-conditions of a sentence depend on (and only on) its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts. The truth-conditions of a sentence are simply the conditions under which the sentence is true. The truth-conditions of a sentence do not depend only on its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts if that sentence is true in some conditions and false in others, even though it has the same syntax and the same assignment of meanings to its simple parts. For example, we will later consider sentences such as ‘It is midnight.’ Sometimes this sentence is true, but other times—apparently without a change in the meanings of the words or in the way they are combined—it is false. This is an apparent violation of the compositionality of truth-conditions.

c. Dependence

Dependence and determination are common and vital notions in philosophy, though they are in many ways ambiguous. Sometimes dependence is a functional notion, as in: “the signs of two numbers determine the sign of their product (the sign of their product depends on their signs).” Dependence can also be a causal notion, as in: “the success of our movie depended on our advertising campaign.” It can be a constitutive notion, as in: “whether I win depends on whether I get a card lower than 4.” Regarding the compositionality thesis, there are many ways the notion of dependence has been understood.

i. Functional Dependence

One way of understanding the sense in which the meaning of the whole, according to compositionality, “depends on” the meanings of the parts, and the way those parts are combined, is reading “depends on” as “is a function of.” That is, a symbolic system is compositional if, and only if, the meaning of each complex expression E in that system is a function of (a) E’s syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

A function is a pairing of an input (an element of its domain) with an output (an element of its range). Familiar functions from mathematics are addition, subtraction, and multiplication. For example, the addition function takes two inputs and returns as output their sum: + takes 2 and 3 as inputs and returns 5 as output. The important thing about functions is that for any sequence of inputs there can only be one output. + never takes two numbers and returns both 5 and 7 as outputs. An example of a mathematical operation that is not a function is √x, because, for instance, √4 has two values, +2 and –2.

While we usually talk about functions only in the context of mathematics, common functions are all around us. Consider the function “(biological) mother of”. The inputs to this function are organisms and the outputs are their (biological) mothers. “(Biological) mother of” is a function because it pairs inputs with outputs and it never pairs the same input with distinct outputs (everyone has only one biological mother).

To say that the meaning of an expression E is a function of its syntactic structure and the meanings of its simple parts is to say that there is a function that takes E’s syntactic structure and the meaning of E’s simple parts as input, and returns as output E’s meaning.

ii. The Substitution Principle

If a language L is compositional in the functional sense described in the previous section, then that language satisfies the substitution principle:

SP: If you take any expression E of L, and any morpheme M that occurs in E, and you replace M with a different morpheme M* of L that has the same meaning as M, then the result will have the same meaning as M.

For example, “Sally perspires” is an expression of English. Let’s assume that ‘perspires’ and ‘sweats’ have the same meaning. Then what SP says is that “Sally sweats” has the same meaning as “Sally perspires.” In other words, substituting an expression with one meaning for another expression with the same meaning does not change the meaning of the whole.

If compositionality is true, then SP is true. Remember that a language is compositional when there is a function that, for every expression E in the language, takes E’s syntactic structure and the meaning of E’s simple parts as input, and returns as output E’s meaning. If in expression E, you replace one of E’s morphemes M with another morpheme M* that has the same meaning as M, then you haven’t changed the inputs to the function: the function takes the meanings of the parts as inputs, and though you’ve changed the parts, they still have the same meaning. Since functions always return the same output when given the same input, the meaning of E-with-M*-replacing-M must be the same as the meaning of E-with-M.

It is also true that if a husserlian language satisfies of the substitution principle, then the language is compositional in the functional sense (see [9]). A language is husserlian if one synonym can be substituted for another synonym without changing the grammaticality of the result. For example, no husserlian language can have synonyms ‘likely’ and ‘probable’ where:

‘It is likely that the Spurs will win’ is grammatical.

‘It is probable that the Spurs will win’ is grammatical.

But:

‘The Spurs are likely to win’ is grammatical.

‘The Spurs are probable to win’ is ungrammatical.

So long as all such pairs as ‘likely’ and ‘probable’ here are assigned different meanings, the substitution principle and the functional conception of compositionality are equivalent.

iii. Problems for Functional Dependence

While the functional conception of compositionality is easy to characterize and understand, it fails to capture the full force of the constraint many philosophers have thought compositionality imposes upon semantic theories for natural languages. This is because many semantic theories which are not intuitively compositional are compositional in the functional sense.

One way to see this is by noting that any symbolic system that contains no synonyms and assigns exactly one meaning to each expression is compositional in the functional sense. If a symbolic system contains no synonyms, the meaning function for that language can’t treat two expressions differing only in the substitution of synonyms differently (because there are no such expressions). Thus for any expression E of S, there is a function F that takes E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s parts as inputs and returns the meaning of E as output. This entails that a non-compositional language could be made compositional solely by removing a few redundant expressions (synonyms of other expressions in the language).

Second, the functional conception of compositionality does not demand any particular relatedness among the meanings of related expressions. The functional conception requires only that the meaning function not assign different meanings to expressions that differ only in the substitution of synonyms. It does not require that the meanings it does assign to complex expressions be in any natural way related to the meanings of their parts, or to the meanings of other complex expressions composed of similar parts. For example, consider these meaning assignments:

Le chien aboie. → The dog barks.
Le chat aboie. → The cat dances.
Le chat pue. → The skunk eats.

Sentences (1) and (2) share a verb, but nothing about their assigned meanings are similar; (2) and (3) share a noun phrase, but again nothing about their assigned meanings is similar. Nevertheless, there exists a function that takes the syntax, and the meanings of the morphemes, of each expression on the left, and maps it to the meaning on the right: it’s displayed in (1)-(3). In fact, any random, unsystematic assignment of meanings to sentences is compatible with the functional conception of compositionality, provided that either there are no synonyms or that sentences that differ only in the substitution of synonyms are assigned the same meaning. This is ‘dependence’ only in the weakest sense of that word.

iv. Dependence as Computability

As we shall see, the principal reason for the belief that natural languages are compositional is that only compositionality can explain how we can figure out the meanings of a large range of novel sentences and expressions, whose meanings we have not specifically learned at any point. Compositionality, construed as computability, says that if you know the syntactic structure of an expression E, and you know the meanings of E’s simple parts, this suffices for you to “work out” the meaning of E: there exists a procedure that you can use, which after a finite number of steps, tells you the meaning of E itself. In other words, the meaning of any expression E is computable from (a) E’s syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of E’s simple parts.

If the meaning of any expression E is computable from E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s simple parts, then it is a function of E’s syntactic structure and the meanings of E’s simple parts. But the converse is not true, for not every function is computable.

While computability imposes some standard of systematicity in meaning assignments, it nevertheless allows more freedom than we might wish. Consider how different programs running on your computer produce wildly different outputs, even given the same sequence of keystrokes. The outputs of the programs are computed from the keystrokes, but they process that information in radically different ways, and produce outputs of radically different characters. The keys used to type the previous sentence in a word processer might result in a complicated series of moves if typed in a fantasy role-playing game. The computability conception of compositionality says that the transition from the syntax of a complex expression and the meanings of its parts to the meaning of that expression must be a function of the syntax and the meanings of the parts, and that it must be rule-governed; but it doesn’t say anything about what the rules are or can be, except that they can be carried out in a finite number of steps and involve no randomness.

v. Dependence as Mereology

The functional and computational conceptions of dependence, with regard to the thesis that natural languages are compositional, are seemingly weaker than the pre-theoretical conception of dependence that occurs in the thesis itself. There is another conception of dependence in the literature that can reasonably be characterized as too strong (though it is not necessarily false that languages are compositional in this sense).

On this conception, the meanings of the parts of a complex expression are literally part of the meaning of that expression. To see how this could be, consider the view that the meaning of a sentence is a structured proposition. The French sentence [[le chien] aboie]—where bracketing indicates syntactic structure—means a structured proposition such as <<the dog> barks>– where the italicized words stand here for the meanings of ‘le,’ ‘chien,’ and ‘aboie,’ respectively. On this view, the meaning of ‘chien,’ for example, is literally a part of the meaning of ‘le chien aboie.’

This notion of dependence is quite strong: the meaning of a complex expression is made out of its syntactic structure and the meanings of its parts. And while many theories of the meanings of complex expressions, such as the theory of structured propositions, validate the principle of compositionality as interpreted with the mereological conception of dependence, it should be clear that this is more than what philosophers normally mean when they say natural languages are compositional.

vi. The Empirical Conception of Dependence

Finally, it’s possible to define compositionality in terms of the role that it plays in explaining certain of our linguistic abilities. In particular, many philosophers have thought that unless the meanings of complex expressions in natural languages depend on (and only on) (a) the syntax of those expressions and (b) the meanings of those expressions’ parts, we would not be able to learn and understand the languages we in fact learn and understand. Thus we can understand “dependence” here as whatever relation in fact obtains between the meaning of a complex expression and that expression’s syntax and the meanings of its parts that in fact explains our ability to learn and understand new expressions whose meanings we have not learned specifically. We know that language is compositional, but it is an empirical question as to just what compositionality consists in.

The empirical conception of compositionality need not be thought of as a competitor to the other conceptions considered above. Instead, it provides a methodological backdrop against which we can evaluate various proposals regarding the sense of “dependence” at the heart of compositionality. As we saw, the functional conception of dependence is ill-favored precisely because it fails to explain our abilities to learn and understand the natural languages we speak. Any proposed account of compositionality not only has to meet certain internal criteria, such as clarity and consistency, but it also has to (a) actually be true of the languages we speak and (b) actually explain our abilities to learn and understand those languages.

There is of course the possibility that no dependence relation that obtains only between the meanings of complex natural language expressions and their syntax and the meanings of their simple parts plays a discernible role in our linguistic abilities. Perhaps the meanings of complex expressions are partly determined by prior discourse, speaker intentions, salient objects and events in the environment, or the non-semantic character of those expressions’ simple parts, such as their shape or sound. In such an event, it might turn out not just that natural languages are not compositional, but that “compositionality” is without application, its introduction having rested on a false presupposition.

2. Arguments for Compositionality

a. Novelty

We are capable of understanding a very large number—perhaps an infinite number—of sentences that we have never heard before. Consider the sentence frame F:

There is a ______ on television.

Anything describable could be written in the blank: orange-and-green polka-dotted squid, shoe sharpener, cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn…. The first thing to notice is that you would understand each of these sentences, even though presumably you’ve never heard them before and no one has ever taught you the meaning of the specific sentence There is a cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn on television. There are quite a lot of things that are describable in English, and so quite a lot of sentences that fit frame F. Each English speaker has only heard a tiny fraction of these sentences before, but every English speaker understands all of them (or at least those containing the English words that she knows).

If we understand the meaning of a new sentence whose meaning we haven’t been specifically taught before, it must be that we can work out its meaning from information available to us when we hear that sentence and other things that we have already learned.

Suppose for a moment that English is a compositional language, in the sense that the meaning of a sentence of English can be computed (worked out) from its syntactic structure and the meanings of its morphemes. This would explain how one could understand a novel utterance such as There is a cauliflower-shaped spacecraft from Saturn on television. English speakers who have never learned the meaning of this sentence specifically have nevertheless learned the meanings of each of the words in it: cauliflower, shape, the past tense morpheme –ed, spacecraft, and so forth. Furthermore, part of mastering a language involves acquiring the ability to parse sentences of that language, that is, to figure out their syntactic structure—for example, figuring out that cauliflower-shaped modifies spacecraft, but on television doesn’t modify Saturn. Thus if English is compositional, English speakers have all they need to understand novel English sentences they have never encountered before—provided those sentences don’t contain unfamiliar words.

We can summarize the argument from novelty as follows:

Premise 1. We are capable of understanding a very large number of English sentences that we have never heard before, whose meanings we have not specifically been taught.

Premise 2. If English is compositional, then English speakers have all the abilities and information they need to understand English sentences they have never encountered before.

Conclusion: The best explanation for the facts described in (1) is that English is in fact compositional.

The premises of the argument from novelty are largely uncontroversial. Since the premises are equally true if ‘English’ is replaced by any other natural language, be it ‘Cantonese’ or ‘Kalaallisut’, the argument suggests that all natural languages are compositional.

As with any inference to the best explanation, however, the argument from novelty is only compelling if there aren’t better or equally good explanations for the target phenomenon—in this case, for English speakers’ ability to understand novel English sentences. It is obvious that if we understand the meaning of a new sentence whose meaning we haven’t been specifically taught before, it must be that we can work out its meaning from information available to us when we hear that sentence and other things that we have already learned. But the information available to us is not limited to (i) the sentence’s syntactic structure and (ii) the meanings of its simple parts. When we hear a novel sentence, we also have information about:

Things said earlier in the conversation
The beliefs or intentions of the person uttering S
Salient objects and events in the environment at the time S is uttered
The non-semantic character of S’s simple parts, such as their shape or sound

If the meaning of a complex expression directly depended on any of these things, we could still explain how English speakers can understand novel utterances, because these are things available to speakers and hearers in a conversation. The argument from novelty can’t by itself establish that all natural languages are compositional, and for that reason it is usually offered with additional arguments for compositionality, to which we now turn.

b. Systematicity

It is commonly argued that the systematicity of natural languages provides good reason to suppose languages are compositional. However, most of the literature fails to provide a clear characterization of systematicity and sometimes very distinct phenomena are all crowded under the one heading.

On the most common way of understanding systematicity, language L is systematic if, and only if, for all expressions E₁, E₂, and E₃ in L, if E₁ can syntactically combine with E₂ to form a grammatical sentence, and E₃ is of the same syntactic category as E₂, then E₁ can combine with E₃ to form a grammatical sentence. For example, the English expression ‘Fred’ can combine with the expression ‘eats bananas’ to form the grammatical sentence ‘Fred eats bananas.’ Since ‘George’ is of the same syntactic category as ‘Fred’ (proper names), if English is systematic then we expect that ‘George eats bananas’ is also a grammatical sentence. Since it is, and since examples such as this are easy to come by, it is often assumed by philosophers that English and other natural languages are systematic, in this sense.

There are reasons to think that English and other natural languages are not systematic in this sense. For example, so-defined, a language is systematic only if its syntactic rules contain no semantic or phonological constraints: it says that any expression can be substituted for any other expression of the same syntactic category, regardless of differences in meaning/ phonology between the two expressions.

Whether a language is systematic, in the sense just discussed, is not obviously relevant to whether it is compositional. After all, systematicity in that sense is only a constraint on which sentences must be grammatical if certain other sentences are grammatical. A language being systematic in that sense is compatible with that language having a non-compositional meaning function.

There is, however, another sense of systematicity that is more difficult to precisely characterize, but which is in fact relevant to whether languages are compositional. Consider these two claims about English: For English expressions E₁, E₂, E₃, and E₄, when the following conditions are met:

E₁ can combine with E₂ to form a grammatical sentence [E₁ E₂].

Example: ‘Dogs’ can combine with ‘chase cars’ to form the sentence ‘Dogs chase cars.’

E₃ can combine with E4 to form a grammatical sentence [E₃ E₄].

Example ‘Cats’ can combine with ‘eat mice’ to form the sentence ‘Cats eat mice.’

E₁ is of the same grammatical category as E₃.
E₂ is of the same grammatical category as E₄.

Then the following two claims hold:

Claim 1: Anyone who can understand [E₁ E₂] and [E₃ E₄] can also understand [E₁ E₄] and [E₃ E₂], when the latter are well-formed.

Example: Anyone who can understand ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘cats eat mice’ can also understand ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’

Claim 2: The meanings of [E₁ E₂] and [E₃ E₄] are predictably related to the meanings of [E₁ E₄] and [E₃ E₂], when the latter are well-formed.

Example: ‘dogs chase cars’ has a meaning that is predictably related to both ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’

It can be argued that any language that is like English in this way is most likely a compositional language. The argument runs as follows. If English is compositional, then understanding ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘cats eat mice’ involves (a) knowing the meanings of all the morphemes in the two sentences and (b) being able to recognize the syntactic structure of both sentences. Furthermore, if English is compositional, such knowledge and abilities suffice to understand ‘dogs eat mice’ and ‘cats chase cars.’ For these sentences are composed of the same morphemes, put together in the same syntactic structures. Thus the best explanation for why Claim 1 is true of English is that English is in fact compositional.

A similar argument can be built around Claim 2. If English is compositional, then the meanings of English expressions are completely determined by (a) their syntactic structure and (b) the meanings of their morphemes. Since the expressions ‘dogs chase cars’ and ‘dogs eat mice’ partially overlap in their morphemes, they partially overlap in what determines their meanings, if compositionality is true. Thus the fact that they have related meanings is some evidence that English is in fact compositional.

Neither of these arguments is very strong on its own, though each may be combined with other arguments or evidence for compositionality to marshal a stronger case. First, it can be argued that Claim 1 and Claim 2 are not true of all English expressions E₁, E₂, E₃, and E₄. With regard to Claim 1, someone might, for instance, know what ‘natural disaster’ and ‘wine selection’ mean without knowing what ‘natural selection’ means. This is because, in particular, the meaning of ‘natural selection’ is not wholly predictable from the meanings of ‘natural’ and ‘selection.’ Finally, both arguments are inferences to the best explanation: they claim, respectively, that the compositionality of English best explains Claim 1, and that it best explains Claim 2. However, there are non-compositional meaning functions that also predict Claims 1 and 2. For example, if the meaning of a complex expression is a function of the meanings of its parts and the phonetic properties of its parts, then it would be no surprise, for instance, that sentences with overlapping morphemes had overlapping meanings. Thus whether compositionality is the best explanation for these claims may depend on what other independent reasons we have for accepting that English is compositional.

c. The Inductive Argument

A third argument for compositionality is predicated on (a) the apparent compositionality of a wide variety of linguistic phenomena and (b) the success of compositional semantics in compositionally analyzing apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena.

Consider a simple English sentence: ‘Jenny loves baseball.’ Even without a well-defined notion of dependence, it is difficult to see how the meaning of this sentence depends on anything other than the meanings of ‘Jenny,’ ‘loves,’ and ‘baseball,’ and the way those words are syntactically combined. External features such as the intentions of a speaker using the sentence on a particular occasion, and the context in which the sentence is used, may well affect what gets implicated by the sentence, but don’t apparently affect its literal meaning. Furthermore, formal features of the sentence, such as the fact that each of the words it contains has two syllables, are also apparently irrelevant to its literal meaning. The meaning of ‘Jenny loves baseball’ apparently depends on, and only on, (a) its syntax and (b) the meanings of its simple parts. This sentence, and a large portion of the language we speak, is apparently compositional.

Now consider a different example: ‘Every girl loves some sport.’ This sentence has two meanings. First, it can mean that for each girl, there is some sport she loves—even if for different girls it’s different sports. For example, if Jenny and Liz are the only girls, the sentence will be true if Jenny loves baseball and no other sport and Liz loves hockey and no other sport. Second, it can mean that there is one particular sport that every girl loves. If Jenny loves only baseball and Liz only hockey, then the sentence is false, because there is no sport loved by all girls. This sentence is therefore apparently non-compositional. On every occasion of use, the sentence appears to have one and the same syntactic structure, and its parts all appear to have the same meanings. If compositionality were true, then, the sentence couldn’t have different meanings on different occasions, because what determines its meaning is the same on all occasions. And yet, it apparently does have different meanings on different occasions.

This is not an argument against the compositionality of English, but rather one for it. The second half of the inductive argument for compositionality concedes that there are indeed a great many apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena in English—this quantifier scope case being just one among them. However, the argument continues, a rather large subset of the great many apparently non-compositional phenomena have been considered by linguists in the past several decades and been given satisfactory compositional analyses. (With regard to our example, the most common solution has been to regard it as really having two syntactic structures, corresponding to its two meanings. See the References and Further Reading.) Since compositional semantics has been such a fruitful and successful research program in the past and there’s no reason to think it will cease to be in the future, we have strong reason to suppose that English is in fact compositional, even if some of it appears not to be.

The inductive argument holds up the past successes of compositional semantics as a good reason to believe that English (and any other language we’ve seriously and successfully investigated) is compositional. However, there remain apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena that have not been given universally agreed upon—or even widely endorsed—compositional analyses (see section 4, Challenges to Compositionality). Some of these cases, such as generic statements, may well have particular features that justify us in thinking that they cannot be given compositional analyses.

One additional point is worth making. A common construal of compositional semantics in linguistics is that the goal is to assign logical forms (LFs) to sentences of natural language in a compositional way. LFs are themselves representations and are not (standardly considered) the same things as meanings. LFs are “in the head,” unlike propositions, states of affairs, situations, truth-conditions, and so forth. Thus, the fact that an LF can be compositionally determined from the (a) syntactic structure of a sentence and (b) the lexical entries for that sentence’s morphemes does not entail that the meaning of the sentence is determined by those things—at least not without further argumentation. Thus the past success of semantic theory could be irrelevant to the question whether natural languages are compositional.

3. The Dialectical Role of Compositionality in Philosophy

a. Real Meanings

Section 1.b endorsed a sort of meaning pluralism, that all proposed meanings (stereotypes, features, referents, senses…) were bona fide meanings and that it made sense to ask whether meaning was compositional, in any of the bona fide senses. But compositionality can also be used as a litmus test for determining which of these meanings is important or relevant to philosophical theorizing, as follows:

X is the Real Meaning of expression E =_df. Understanding E requires pairing it with X.

The Real Meaning of an expression is the meaning whose grasp is both necessary and sufficient for understanding that expression. This notion of Real Meaning can then be used to discredit various meanings that are not compositional, as follows. As the argument from novelty suggests, our ability to understand new sentences whose meanings we have not specifically learned, requires that we compute those meanings from the sentences’ syntactic structures and the meanings of their parts. Thus, the Real Meaning of complex expressions in English must be compositionally determined. Therefore, if Y-meanings are not compositionally determined, then Y-meanings aren’t Real Meanings.

b. Semantic Theories Purportedly at Odds with Compositionality

The principle of compositionality has been employed in arguments against almost every semantic theory, including theories in metaethics of the meaning of normative terms. Presented here are four illustrative examples: first, Frege’s puzzle for the “naïve theory” of meaning of names, that names mean what they name; second, two very standard cases of discrediting theories (in this case, conceptual role semantics and verificationism) with the principle of compositionality; finally, the Frege-Geach problem for non-cognitivist theories in metaethics. Other examples can be found in References and Further Reading.

i. Direct Reference Theory

According to the “naïve theory” of the meaning of proper names (often also called the direct reference theory) the meaning of a name is its referent, the thing it names. If the direct reference theory is true and compositionality is true, it follows that two sentences that differ only in the substitution of one co-referring name for another will mean the same thing. For example, sentences (a) and (b) will mean the same thing, because “Lady Gaga” and “Stefani Germanotta” both refer to the same person:

(a) Lady Gaga is a professional singer.

(b) Stefani Germanotta is a professional singer.

This seems like a reasonable position. Whenever (a) is true, (b) is also true, and vice versa. So (a) and (b) have the same truth-conditions, and it’s reasonable to then think they have the same meaning. But now consider two other sentences that are like (a) and (b) in that they differ only in the substitution of one co-referring name for another:

(d) Elaine expects to see Stefani Germanotta.

Since Lady Gaga is Stefani Germanotta, the direct reference theory (plus compositionality) predicts that (c) and (d) have the same meaning. But prima facie, it seems that (c) could be true and (d) false, or (d) true and (c) false. Elaine may have heard Lady Gaga on the radio, and purchased a ticket to her concert, completely oblivious to the fact that Lady Gaga is Stefani Germanotta. She expects to see Gaga, but would be very surprised to learn she was to see Germanotta. She might even become angry at learning that Germanotta will be performing all night, because she prefers to see Gaga.

It follows that three things are inconsistent: (i) our naïve judgments regarding the truth-conditions of (c) and (d); (ii) the direct reference theory; and (iii) the thesis that English is compositional. This is called “Frege’s Puzzle” after Gottlob Frege, who first posed it. Some philosophers have taken it as a reason to reject the direct reference theory.

ii. Conceptual Role Semantics

According to the inferentialist, the meaning of a simple sentence of the form x is an F is the set of sentences we can infer are (probably) true, assuming x is an F. For example, the meaning of “This is a tree” would be a set of sentences containing things such as “This has leaves,” “This is a plant,” “This has branches,” “This grows,” “This is relatively stationary,” and so forth. The inferentialist further holds that the meaning of a complex sentence is also the set of sentences we can infer are (probably) true from it. This is a variety of conceptual role semantics.

Now consider the sentence “This is a green fish.” Green fish are relatively uncommon, so plausibly you can infer “This is rare” from “This is a green fish,” and thus according to conceptual role semantics “This is rare” is an element of the meaning of “This is a green fish.” However, neither green things nor fish are uncommon in nature. So “This is rare” is not an element of the meaning of either “This is green” or “This is a fish.”

This is just one example of the broader principle that the normal features of things that are F and G are not a function of the normal features of things that are F and the normal features of things that are G. Thus, the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are F and G will not be a function of the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are F and the set of sentences expressing the normal features of things that are G. That is, this version of conceptual role semantics is incompatible with compositionality.

iii. Verificationism

Compositionality presents analogous troubles for theories that are similar to conceptual role semantics, such as the theory that the meaning of a sentence is the set of experiences that confirm it or the theory that the meaning of an expression is a stereotype. Suppose that the meaning of a sentence S is the set of experiences E such that E raises the probability that S is true.

For the sake of the example, suppose that cows comprise a tiny proportion of the dangerous animals, and that brown animals also comprise a tiny proportion of the dangerous animals. Further, all dangerous cows are brown and all dangerous brown animals are cows. Now suppose you encounter one and only one animal and experience E an animal-mauling. E lowers the probability that the animal was brown, because most dangerous animals are not-brown. E lowers the probability that the animal was a cow, because most dangerous animals are non-cows. But E raises the probability that the animal was a brown cow.

The set of experiences that confirms this is a brown cow is not a function of the set of experiences that confirms this is a brown thing and the set of experiences that confirms this is a cow. Thus verificationism is incompatible with compositionality.

iv. Moral Non-Cognitivism

According to the expressivist, sentences involving normative terminology such as ‘good’ and ‘bad’ and ‘right’ and ‘wrong’ play a different role in communication than ordinary descriptive sentences, containing no such terminology. For example, when George says something descriptive, such as “figure-skating is difficult,” he is expressing his belief that figure-skating is difficult. The role of descriptive statements is to express one’s beliefs. But, according to the expressivist, the role of normative terminology is to express one’s approval or disapproval. When George says something normative, such as “figure-skating is right” or “figure skating is wrong,” he is expressing his approval or disapproval of figure-skating.

Consider the sentence, “figure-skating is not wrong.” What does this sentence express? It’s not disapproval of figure-skating, obviously, because that’s what the expressivist thinks “figure-skating is wrong” means. But neither is it approval of figure-skating. You can think something is not wrong without thinking that it is right—figure-skating, for instance, is neither right nor wrong. It is morally neutral; it is morally permissible. Expressivist accounts then say that “figure-skating is not wrong” expresses the speaker’s toleration of figure-skating.

This treatment raises a question: Does the expressivist meaning of “figure-skating is not wrong” depend on and only on the expressivist meaning of “figure-skating is wrong” and the meaning of “not”? At first glance, it would seem that the answer is “no.” According to the expressivist, when George says “figure-skating is wrong” what this expresses is DIS:

DIS. George disapproves of figure skating.

So when George says instead, “figure-skating is not wrong,” this should express something that is a combination of DIS and the meaning of “not.” Two options suggest themselves:

~DIS. George does not disapprove of figure-skating.

DIS~. George disapproves of not figure-skating.

But neither ~DIS nor DIS~ says the same thing as George tolerates figure-skating, which is the meaning of “figure-skating is not wrong,” according to the expressivist. ~DIS is consistent with George having no opinion regarding figure-skating. But tolerating figure-skating—thinking that it is not wrong, that it is an acceptable form of behavior—is having an opinion of figure-skating. It’s having the opposite opinion to one who thinks figure-skating is wrong. DIS~ is also not the meaning the expressivist wants. Tolerating figure-skating is not the same thing as disapproving of those who don’t skate. You can tolerate a behavior without being intolerant of those who don’t engage in it.

This is “the negation problem” for expressivism but it is just part of a broader set of problems for moral non-cognitivist theories in meta-ethics. The broader set of problems—often called the Frege-Geach problem—regards how non-cognitivist theories can deal with logically complex normative sentences (involving words such as “not,” “or,” and “if… then…”) and logical inferences.

4. Challenges to Compositionality

There is no end of linguistic phenomena that have been presented as challenges to the thesis that natural languages are compositional. The examples that follow are therefore intended to illustrate the sorts of problems the compositionality thesis faces, rather than constitute an exhaustive overview.

Section 4a considers an attempt to undermine the dialectical purpose of compositionality by showing that any meaning theory is compatible with the principle of compositionality. Section 4b focuses on context-sensitive expressions. Here Kaplan’s distinction between character and content is introduced as well as the strategy of handling apparently non-compositional phenomena by positing so-called “hidden indexicals.” The key idea introduced in this section is that while compositionality requires that the meanings of complex expressions depend only on their syntactic structure and the meanings of their morphemes, it allows simple expression meanings to depend on anything, including context, speaker intentions, and so on.

Section 4c covers the case of idioms. Although there are plenty of non-compositional idioms, this is not as devastating to the compositionality supporter as one might think. The key idea in 4c is that allowing exceptions to the principle of compositionality in cases where we have specifically learned the meaning of a complex expression doesn’t hurt the dialectical purposes that principle is mainly used for. A real problem for compositionality would be a large number of cases where we are able to understand complex expressions we have never heard before and those expressions are not compositional. Section 4d covers a productive construction in English that seems to suggest just such a problem for compositionality: noun modification.

a. The Triviality Objection

Consider the following argument: the debate over whether natural languages are compositional is pointless. Any language can be given a compositional semantics, for any proposed theory of what meanings are. If meanings are ideas, then we let the meaning of [dogs [chase cats]] be [the idea of dogs [the idea of chasing, the idea of cats]]. If meanings are stereotypes, then we let the meaning of [dogs [chase cats]] be [the stereotype of dogs [the stereotype of chasing, the stereotype of cats]], and so on. In general, the meaning of any complex expression is just that very expression, with the meanings of its simple parts in place of those parts. (This is a type of structured propositions view.)

There are two main reasons the triviality objection fails to convince most philosophers. First, while one can give such meaning theories for complex expressions, these meaning theories conflict with other principles that seem reasonable to hold. For example, we might think that the meaning of ‘cow’ and the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should be the same general type of thing. If the meaning of ‘cow’ is an idea, the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should also be an idea; if the meaning of ‘cow’ is a property—such as the property of being a cow—then the meaning of ‘brown cow’ should also be a property—such as the property of being a brown cow. But according to the triviality objection, we must say instead that while ‘cow’ means the idea of a cow, ‘brown cow’ means a structured complex containing two ideas: the idea of brown and the idea of a cow.

Second, even if structured propositions don’t violate any of our other commitments, most structured propositionalists believe that the structured proposition that is the meaning of a sentence determines the truth-conditions of that sentence. And it is far from obvious that one can work out the truth-conditions of ‘this is my pet fish’ from a structured proposition containing the stereotype of a pet and the stereotype of a fish. It is not a trivial question to ask whether the truth-conditions of a sentence depend on (and only on) that sentence’s syntax and the meanings of its simple parts.

b. Context-Sensitive Expressions

Consider the sentence ‘I am Socrates.’ Sometimes when the sentence is uttered, it is true; at other times it is false. Although we might try to defend the claim that true utterances of ‘I am Socrates’ have a different syntactic structure from false utterances of ‘I am Socrates,’ this seems wholly implausible. Clearly the truth or falsity of the sentence depends on who is saying the sentence.

At first, this might seem like proof that the truth-conditions of English sentences are not determined compositionally. Here is the argument: suppose that Aristotle says, ‘I am Socrates.’ This sentence is false because its truth-value depends on who says it: it is true only if the person who says it is Socrates. However, Aristotle is not the meaning of ‘am’ or ‘Socrates,’ as anyone can tell. Aristotle is also not the meaning of ‘I,’ otherwise when Socrates says ‘I am Socrates’ he would mean ‘Aristotle is Socrates.’ So the truth-value of ‘I am Socrates’ depends on something that is not its syntactic structure and is not the meanings of any of the words comprising it. And it doesn’t help to say that ‘I’ means ‘the person saying this sentence,’ because now we are faced with the exact same problem: sometimes ‘The person saying this sentence is Socrates’ is true and sometimes it is false. But it has the same syntactic structure and its morphemes mean the same thing on both the true occasions of utterance and the false ones.

Now we can unravel what’s going on here. There is one sense in which ‘I’ has the same meaning every time it is used. We can call this the character of ‘I.’ There is another sense in which ‘I’ has a different meaning when different people use it. Call this the content of ‘I.’ Character is a rule for determining content. The rule for ‘I’ is: the content of ‘I’ any time it is used is the person who is using it. So when Aristotle and Socrates both use the word ‘I’ it has different contents for each use—Aristotle and Socrates, respectively—but those contents are determined by one and the same character (rule). The truth of ‘I am Socrates,’ when used by any particular person, is completely determined by (and only by) the syntax of the sentence and the contents of its morphemes.

English has a variety of expressions that differ in content from context to context. We call these context-sensitive expressions:

Now, today, yesterday, tomorrow
Here, there, local, nearby
I, you, he, she, it, they, we
Come, go, left, right
This, that, these, those
Thus, so, yea

Some of these have characters that determine their contents with no interpretation necessary. ‘Today’ always names the day on which it is used. The rule for ‘that,’ however, is roughly that its content is whatever the speaker intends.

The general point here is that compositionality requires that the meaning of a complex expression not be determined ‘directly’ by context or by speaker intentions. However, a language can still be compositional if its simple expressions have their meanings (contents) determined by context or by speaker intentions.

Some philosophers have proposed compositional analyses of various apparently non-compositional phenomena that appeal to unwritten, unspoken context-sensitive expressions (“hidden indexicals”). For example, consider the sentence, ‘There is no beer.’ It might mean on different occasions: there is no beer on this menu; there is no beer at this party; there is no beer in this bottle, and so on. This could be because the sentence ‘There is no beer’ has its meaning determined by factors other than the meanings of its parts and the way they are combined. Alternatively, it could be because there is a hidden indexical ‘there’ that is really part of the sentence. The indexical, though present, is not written or spoken. Nevertheless, it contributes its context-sensitive content to the meaning of the sentence, thus accounting for the variability in the sentence’s truth-value from context to context. There is nothing theoretically problematic about such a hidden indexical account, but it should be emphasized that whether hidden indexicals exist in these cases is an empirical question that might turn out to be false.

c. Idioms

The term ‘idiom’ covers a wide range of expressions, including stale metaphors (she’s on the fence, he ran out of steam), common hyperboles (he drinks like a fish, there was no room to swing a cat), and even common phrases (she’s last but not least, there’s method to his madness). To the extent that we don’t think metaphor or hyperbole pose any trouble for the thesis that natural languages are compositional these types of idioms appear equally benign.

However, there are some idioms whose meanings cannot be worked out by someone familiar only with their syntax and the meanings of their parts and whose meanings can’t be understood as implicatures. Consider idioms such as she let the cat out of the bag, or I think he’s pulling your leg. Understanding these complex expressions requires learning their meanings in advance, separate from the meanings of their parts. In fact, many idioms contain ‘words’ that do not otherwise occur in the language, or only occur with different meanings (that’s beyond the pale, this is an old wives’ tale).

It is not uncommon for philosophers to assert that compositionality admits of finitely many exceptions, and as there are only finitely many idioms in any language, compositionality is not violated. This is not strictly speaking true. The most general formulation of compositionality—the meaning of any complex expression depends on and only on its syntax and the meanings of its parts—admits of no exceptions, nor do many of its various precisifications—for example, reading ‘depends on’ as ‘is a function of,’ or ‘can be computed from.’

On the assumption that ‘kick the bucket’ has the same syntax, and simple parts with the same meanings, in both its idiomatic and its non-idiomatic meaning, its meaning is not a function of its syntax and the meanings of its simple parts, for functions have unique outputs. The substitution test fails: ‘kicked the pail’ does not have the same meaning as the idiomatic ‘kicked the bucket,’ despite having the same syntax and parts with the same meanings. In a more intuitive sense, the meaning of ‘kicked the bucket’ doesn’t depend on the meanings of ‘kick’ and ‘bucket’—those meanings, the act of kicking and bucket are neither here nor there with respect to the idiomatic meaning of ‘kick the bucket.’

Here is what motivates the common refrain that “compositionality admits of finitely many exceptions.” Recall that the argument from novelty says that the best explanation for our ability to understand complex expressions whose meanings we have not been specifically taught is that those expressions have their meanings determined compositionally. The argument from novelty is irrelevant to complex expressions whose meanings we have been specifically taught. This includes the problematic idioms. No one understands “she let the cat out of the bag” or “he’s just pulling your leg” before they have been taught the specific meaning of those idioms. What the argument from novelty suggests is that new complex expressions must be composed only of expressions whose meanings we have learned specifically before—but these latter expressions can be simple like “dog” or complex like “let the cat out of the bag.”

While idioms may demonstrate that not all complex expressions have their meanings determined compositionally, it is important to note that compositionality may still serve its dialectical role. The argument from novelty shows that sentences we can understand without having learned their meaning specifically must have meanings that depend on parts whose meanings we have learned specifically. Thus we still have reason to doubt that the Real Meaning of “this is a green fish” is its inferential role, because (i) “this is a green fish” is the sort of sentence English speakers can understand without having learned its meaning specifically (unlike, for instance, “she let the cat out of the bag”) and (ii) as we’ve seen, the inferential role of “this is a green fish” does not depend on the inferential roles of “this is green” and “this is a fish.”

Nevertheless, idioms could still pose a threat to the claim that novel expressions are compositional, if it turns out there are non-compositional idioms we can understand, even though we have not been specifically taught their meanings. For example, consider the class of expressions that involve a VERB + the removal of relatively irremovable things to mean something like VERB-ed excessively: she cried her eyes out/ laughed her head off/ worked her butt off/ danced the night away… It might be that we can recognize novel instances of patterns like this, in ways that don’t involve calculating their meanings from the meanings of their parts. How exactly we process the meanings of sentences containing idioms is as of now an open question, and it might turn out that we speak a language that violates the principle of compositionality even for novel expressions.

d. Noun Modification

English nouns can be combined with other English nouns to form compound nouns—for example, ‘truck driver,’ ‘panda trainer,’ ‘demolition derby,’ and so forth. This process is productive: ‘You are reading the compositionality philosophy encyclopedia entry compounds section’ (the section on compounds from the entry in the encyclopedia of philosophy about compositionality).

One interesting aspect of noun compounds in English is that they do not specify the relation between the two nouns, and this relation differs from occasion to occasion. A house boat, for example, is a boat used as a house; but a boat house is not a house used as a boat, it’s a house for your boat to live in. A dog house is a house for a dog to live in, but a house dog is not a dog for a house to live in, nor is it a dog used as a house, it’s a dog that lives exclusively in the house. (Still more relations abound: brick house, house appraisal, house party…)

While we might treat many compounds simply as idioms there are two general additional problems they pose: their productivity, as stated, and also the fact that nonce or novel compounds are regularly understood. Consider these examples:

Example 1: We are at a child’s birthday party, about to eat ice cream. There are several spoons, each of which has a different animal depicted on it. I tell you, “You can have the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon with a dog depiction on it.

Example 2: Similar birthday party scenario. This time there are only normal spoons. Unfortunately, there are only as many spoons as guests, and the dogs at the party have gotten ahold of one of them and slobbered all over it. I tell you, “Sorry, there’s no ice cream for you, unless you want the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon that the dogs have been playing with.

Example 3: You and I are shopping for a friend who likes to collect spoons. We find some very nice Chinese commemorative spoons from different years. With the background knowledge that our friend was born in the year of the dog, and that only one spoon is from the year of the dog, I say “Let’s get the dog spoon.” You immediately recognize that I mean the spoon that commemorates a year that is also a year of the dog in the Chinese zodiac.

In each of the examples, ‘dog’ means the same thing it always does, because ‘dog’ is not an indexical such as ‘I’ or ‘today’ and does not have different contents on different occasions. Similarly, in each of these examples, ‘spoon’ means the same thing it always does, because ‘spoon’ is not an indexical either. These two words exhaust the morphemes in the expression ‘dog spoon.’ Furthermore, in each of the examples, the syntax of ‘dog spoon’ is the same. And yet, in each of the examples, the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ is different. These facts, if they are facts, are straightforwardly incompatible with the claim that the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ depends on and only on its syntax and the meanings of its morphemes. These examples seem to show that the meaning of ‘dog spoon’ is context-sensitive because it directly depends on context, not because its parts are context-sensitive.

Similar remarks can be made for the English possessive “Heather’s horse”: in separate contexts it can mean: the horse that Heather owns; the horse that Heather has wagered money on; the horse that Heather is currently riding; the horse that shares a name with Heather, and so on. If ‘Heather’, ‘horse,’ and the English possessive morpheme ‘-s’ don’t change their meanings from context to context, then it appears that the meaning of ‘Heather’s horse’ depends directly on context, and is thus not compositional.

Indeed, modification in English generally allows context-specific interpretations: ‘green leaf” in different contexts could mean a leaf that is green on the outside, a leaf that is green on the inside, a leaf that is normally (but not now) green, a leaf depicted in the green volume of a color-coded set of volumes on leaves, and so on. Again, although ‘green leaf’ is context-sensitive, its parts, ‘green’ and ‘leaf’ do not appear to be. This direct dependence of the meaning of a complex expression on context is a violation of compositionality.

There are various attempts at compositional solutions to the problem posed by compound nouns. There are two general strategies: first, one can deny that ‘dog spoon’ or ‘Heather’s horse’ or ‘green leaf’ differ in meaning from one occasion to the next. Second, one can accept that expressions such as these are context-sensitive, but argue that they do contain context-sensitive parts (for example, hidden indexicals) that explain the context-sensitivity.

As an example of the first strategy, some philosophers and linguists have argued that “dog spoon” means only “spoon somehow related to a dog or dogs.” More generally they say that any noun compound N₁ N₂ means “N₂ somehow related to a N₁ or N₁s.” In this way, noun compounds are assigned fixed, non-context-sensitive meanings that only depend on their syntax and the meanings of their parts. Such accounts have unintuitive consequences, to say the least: every time there is a toilet somehow related to paper, there is paper somehow related to a toilet. But it doesn’t obviously follow that whenever there is toilet paper, there are paper toilets. Furthermore, extending the strategy to possessives looks disastrous: If [N₁ [POS N₂]] means “N₂ somehow related to N₁,” then no matter which horse wins the race, Heather’s horse wins the race, because Heather is somehow related to all of them.

An example of the second strategy is to posit a “hidden indexical.” The idea is that ‘dog spoon’ means ‘spoon that bears relation R to dogs,’ where R is a relation-indexical that picks out different relations in different contexts, in the way ‘he’ picks out different males in different contexts. This strategy requires positing a large number of hidden indexicals: whenever nouns are modified by nouns, possessives, or adjectives. As previously discussed, there is nothing theoretically problematic with such solutions, but whether there are such indexicals in these cases is an empirical matter that may well be shown to be false.

5. Conclusion

The principle of compositionality plays a central role in the evaluation of theories of meaning. If the principle is true, or is true with only a constrained class of exceptions, many if not all current theories of meaning may turn out to be inadequate. This includes a number of popular non-cognitivist positions in metaethics. Despite its centrality, it is difficult to say precisely what the principle of compositionality requires, both because philosophers are divided on what exactly meanings are and because of the nebulousness of “dependence.” Furthermore, there are a number of productive, apparently non-compositional linguistic phenomena. If the principle of compositionality is untrue, we have to find some other way to explain how humans learn and understand productive languages.

6. References and Further Reading

a. General

There are several overviews of compositionality that have distinct focuses from this article. Readers are warned that much of the secondary literature on compositionality is very technical. Item [2] provides a formal framework for studying variants of compositionality and then surveys many such variants; it requires at least rudimentary knowledge of metalogic. Item [3] is a survey of issues concerning compositionality in Montague semantics; readers should have at least some familiarity with formal semantics in the Montagovian tradition.

[1] Dever, J. 2006. “Compositionality.” In E. Lepore & B. Smith (eds.), The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Language. Oxford University Press: pp. 633-666.
[2] Pagin, P. & Westerståhl, D. 2009. “Compositionality I: Definitions and Variants.” Philosophy Compass 5.3: pp. 250-264.
[3] Partee, B. 2004. “Chapter 7: Compositionality” In her Compositionality in Formal Semantics: Selected Papers by Barbara Partee. John Wiley & Sons.

b. Frege’s Principle

The principle of compositionality is often called “Frege’s Principle,” because Frege is often considered the source or inspiration for the principle. However, it’s a matter of serious scholarly debate whether Frege did, in fact, hold the principle for either of the two kinds of meaning he recognized (Sinn and Bedeutung, or sense and reference). The curious reader is directed to [4] and [5]. Item [5] argues that while Frege held the principle of compositionality of reference (in the form of the substitution principle), there is no good evidence that he thought senses were likewise compositional. (This article also helpfully contains a wide variety of scholarly articulations of what compositionality is.) [4] argues that Frege did not even hold that the referent of a sentence was determined by its syntactic structure and the referents of its parts, because sentences’ referents vary, according to Frege, in ways that directly depend on context.

[4] Janssen, T. 2001. “Frege, Contextuality and Compositionality” Journal of Logic, Language and Information Vol. 10: pp. 115-136.
[5] Pelletier, F. 2001. “Did Frege Believe Frege’s Principle?” Journal of Logic, Language and Information Vol. 10: pp. 87-114.

c. Dependence

Item [9] clarifies the relation between the substitution principle and the functional conception of compositionality. [8] is the locus classicus for the claim that compositionality involves a stronger notion of dependence, computability, than mere functional dependence. [11] is an elaboration and defense of the claim that dependence in the principle of compositionality is supervenience. [7] claims that compositionality is the principle that the meanings of complex expressions are “constructed from” the meanings of its parts and presents the principle of reverse compositionality (in the section “Compositionality and the Lexicon”) and [10] forcefully argues against that principle. [6] defends the empirical conception of dependence.

[6] Dowty, D. 2007. “Compositionality as an Empirical Problem.” In C. Barker & P. Jacobson (eds.), Direct Compositionality, Oxford University Press: pp. 23-101.
[7] Fodor, J. & Lepore, E. 2001. “Why Compositionality Won’t Go Away: Reflections on Horwich’s ‘Deflationary’ Theory.” Ratio 14.4: pp. 350-368.
[8] Grandy, R. 1990. “Understanding and the Principle of Compositionality.” Philosophical Perspectives 4: pp. 557-572.
[9] Hodges, W. 2001. “Formal Features of Compositionality.” Journal of Logic, Language and Information 10 (1): pp. 7-28
[10] Johnson, K. 2006. “On the Nature of Reverse Compositionality.” Erkenntnis 64 (1): pp. 37 – 60.
[11] Szabó, Z. 2000. “Compositionality as Supervenience.” Linguistics and Philosophy, 23: pp. 475-505.

d. Novelty

Most papers on compositionality involve some discussion of the argument from novelty. [12] is the first explicit statement of the argument and the catalyst for contemporary discussions of it.

[12] Davidson, D. 2001. “Theories of meaning and learnable languages.” In his Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation. Clarendon Press: pp. 3-16.

e. Systematicity

There are two separate bodies of literature on systematicity. First, there are arguments for and against certain views of cognitive architecture involving a syntactic notion of systematicity. The opening volley is [15]. Item [13] contains a thorough discussion of how to understand this notion of systematicity, and [16] and [17] carefully consider whether natural language is systematic in this sense. The other semantic sense of systematicity and the argument for compositionality based on it can be found in a number of Fodor’s works, including [14] pp. 106-107.

[13] Cummins, R. 1996. “Systematicity.” Journal of Philosophy 93: pp. 591-614.
[14] Fodor, J. 1994. “Concepts: A Potboiler.” Cognition 50: pp. 95-113.
[15] Fodor, J. & Pylyshyn, Z. 1988. “Connectionism and Cognitive Architecture.” Cognition 28: pp. 3-71.
[16] Johnson, K. 2004. “On the Systematicity of Language and Thought.” Journal of Philosophy 101: pp. 111-139.
[17] Pullum, G. & Scholz, B. 2007. “Systematicity and Natural Language Syntax.” Croatian Journal of Philosophy 21: pp. 375-402.

f. Compositionality vs. Theories of Meaning

Frege’s Puzzle originally occurs in [18]. There is a large literature on the puzzle; [23] is one detailed defense of the naïve theory. [19] is one of many examples of arguments against conceptual-role semantics using the principle of compositionality. Michael Dummett developed a sophisticated conceptual-role semantics; [22] is an excellent overview, as well as an argument that Dummett’s semantics too is non-compositional. The Frege-Geach problem appears in [20] and [25]. Hare casts the problem in terms of compositionality in [21]. [24] provides an accessible overview.

[18] Frege, G. 1997. “On Sinn and Bedeutung (1892).” In M. Beaney (ed.), The Frege Reader: pp. 151-171.
[19] Fodor, J. & Lepore E. 1993. “Why Compositionality (Probably) Isn’t Conceptual Role.” Philosophical Issues 3, Science and Knowledge: pp. 15-35.
[20] Geach, P. 1965. “Assertion.” Philosophical Review 74: pp. 449-465.
[21] Hare, R. 1970. “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 79: pp. 3-24.
[22] Pagin, P. 2009. “Compositionality, Understanding, and Proofs.” Mind 118 (471): pp. 713-737.
[23] Salmon, N. 1986. Frege’s Puzzle. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
[24] Schroeder, M. 2008. “What Is the Frege-Geach Problem?” Philosophy Compass 3/4: pp. 703-720.
[25] Searle, J. 1962. “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 71: pp. 423-432.

g. Triviality

Item [28] presents the triviality argument considered in this article. Items [7] and [27] are two different attempts at undermining Horwich’s conclusions. A distinct triviality argument is presented in [29]; [26] provides a response. Familiarity with formal logic is required for [29] and [26].

[26] Dever, J. 1999. “Compositionality as Methodology.” Linguistics and Philosophy 22: pp. 311-326.
[27] Heck, R. 2013. “Is Compositionality a Trivial Principle?” Frontiers of Philosophy in China 8 (1): pp. 140-55
[28] Horwich, P. 1997. “The Composition of Meanings.” Philosophical Review 106: pp. 503-532.
[29] Zadrozny, W. 1994. “From Compositional to Systematic Semantics.” Linguistics and Philosophy 17.4: pp. 329-342.

h. Context-Sensitive Expressions

Item [31] is a classic and informs most contemporary work on context-sensitive expressions. [32] is an admirably clear treatment of what the principle of compositionality does and does not say about context-sensitivity. [33] began a debate about “unarticulated constituents”: aspects of meaning that are contextually supplied, but not compositionally derived. [30], [34], and [35] are three different contemporary perspectives in the debate.

[30] Carston, R. 2000. Explicature and Semantics. UCL Working Papers in Linguistics 12.1.
[31] Kaplan, D. 1989. “Demonstratives.” In J. Almog, J. Perry, & H. Wettstein (eds.) Themes from Kaplan: pp. 481–563.
[32] Lasersohn, P. 2012 “Contextualism and Compositionality.” Linguistics and Philosophy, Vol. 35.2: pp. 171-189.
[33] Perry, J. 1986. “Thought without Representation.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes: pp. 137-166.
[34] Recanati, F. 2010. Truth Conditional Pragmatics. Oxford University Press.
[35] Stanley, J. 2002. “Making It Articulated.” Mind & Language 17: pp. 149-168.

i. Idioms

Readers interested in idioms should begin with [36] and follow its bibliography for more references.

[36] Nunberg, G., Sag, I., Wasow, T. 1994. “Idioms.” Language, Vol. 70, No. 3: pp. 491-538.

j. Noun Modification

Noun compounds, possessives, and modification of nouns with color adjectives provide instructive case studies regarding how philosophers, linguists, and psychologists confront apparently non-compositional phenomena. [37] is a classic, accessible source for observation, experiment, and linguistic analysis of noun compounds. [41] defends the thesis that compound [N1 N2] means “N2 somehow related to a N1 or N1s,” and [44] defends a hidden indexical solution. [40] is a good overview of the issues regarding the semantic treatment of possessives. A number of papers by Travis, including [43], have articulated the problem color adjectives present for the compositionality of truth-conditions. [42] presents a hidden indexical solution, and [38] attempts to use more standard resources to solve the problem. The psychological literature on noun modification typically eschews compositional treatments and goes under the heading “conceptual combination.” [39] is a review of the major psychological theories of processing modified nouns.

[37] Downing, P. 1977. “On the Creation and Use of English Compound Nouns.” Language 53.4: pp. 810-842.
[38] Kennedy, C. & McNally, L. 2010. “Color, Context, and Compositionality.” Synthese 174.1: pp. 79-98.
[39] Murphy, G. 2002. “Conceptual Combination.” In his The Big Book of Concepts. The MIT Press: pp. 443-75.
[40] Partee, B. “Chapter 15: Some Puzzles of Predicate Possessives.” In her Compositionality in Formal Semantics: Selected Papers by Barbara Partee. John Wiley & Sons.
[41] Sainsbury, R. 2001. “Two ways to smoke a cigarette.” Ratio 14: pp. 386-406.
[42] Szabó, Z. 2001. “Adjectives in Context.” In I. Kenesei & R Harnish (eds.) Perspectives on Semantics, Pragmatics and Discourse: A Festschrift for Ferenc Kiefer. Amsterdam: John Benjamins: pp. 119-146.
[43] Travis, C. 1997. “Pragmatics.” In B. Hale & C. Wright (eds.) A Companion to the Philosophy of Language. Blackwell: pp. 87-107.
[44] Weiskopf, D. 2007. “Compound Nominals, Context, and Compositionality.” Synthese, 156: pp. 161-204.

k. Additional Problems

There are a number of additional phenomena that have been seen as challenges to the principle of compositionality. Quotation as a problem for the principle of compositionality goes back at least to [18]. [45] presents a unique attempt to give a compositional treatment of quotation. [46] and [48] include treatments of so-called “donkey sentences.” The representations assigned by Kamp’s Discourse Representation Theory ([48] and other work) are unabashedly non-compositional. [47] and [49] involve a challenge for compositionality involving the interaction of ‘unless’ with quantifiers.

[45] Davidson, D. 1968. “On Saying That.” Synthese 19: pp. 130-146.
[46] Heim, I. 1982. The Semantics of Definite and Indefinite Noun Phrases. Ph.D. dissertation. Department of Linguistics. University of Massachusetts, Amherst.
[47] Higginbotham, J. 1986. “Linguistic Theory and Davidson’s Program in Semantics.” In E. Lepore (ed.) The Philosophy of Donald Davidson: Perspectives on Truth and Interpretation. Oxford: Blackwell.
[48] Kamp, H. 1981. “A Theory of Truth and Semantic Representation”. In: J. Groenendijk, T. Janssen & M. Stokhof (eds.) Formal Methods in the Study of Language. Mathematical Centre Tracts 135, Amsterdam: pp. 277-322.
[49] Pelletier, F. “On an Argument against Semantic Compositionality.” In D. Prawits & D. Westerståhl (eds.) Logic and Philosophy of Science in Uppsala. Kluwer: pp. 599-610.

l. Additional References

[50] Bittner, M. 1995. “Quantification in Eskimo: A Challenge for Compositional Semantics.” In E. Bach, E. Jelinek, A. Kratzer, B. Partee (eds.), Quantification in Natural Language. Kluwer: pp. 59–80.

Author Information

Michael Johnson
Email: michael.dracula.johnson@gmail.com
Hong Kong University
Hong Kong

Chinese Philosophy: Overview of Topics

If Chinese philosophy may be said to have begun around 2000 B.C.E., then it represents the longest continuous heritage of philosophical reflection. Trying to mention each philosopher or every significant thinker is not possible. This article is highly selective by choosing philosophers according to two basic principles: (1) Those who are the most representative of the key contributions of China to philosophical topics worldwide, and (2) those who made substantial redirections on a fundamental question of philosophy. Excluded are those who followed the grammar and approach from earlier thinkers, and who engaged more specifically in what might be called internecine debates and refinements.

The positions of the thinkers covered are grouped under the topics of ontology, epistemology, moral theory, and political philosophy. Fundamental questions belonging to these categories show up in Chinese philosophy, just as they do in Western thought. There are questions Chinese thinkers do not ask or do not approach in the same way as Western philosophers, so gaining an appreciation for why Chinese philosophy has sometimes followed a different path from that taken in the West is itself instructive. This overview is designed to pique the interest of readers, encouraging them to pursue the ways in which Chinese thinkers have made significant contributions to topics of interest in world philosophy.

Ontology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Composition of Reality
Epistemology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Scope of Knowledge
Moral Theory: Fundamental Questions on Morality
Political Philosophy: Fundamental Questions on Society and Government
Epilogue
References and Further Reading

1. Ontology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Composition of Reality

Western philosophy often takes the theory of reality (ontology) as equivalent to metaphysics, but this term does not fit for Chinese philosophy as it implies there is something beyond nature that creates and guides reality from the outside. While Chinese philosophical thought has a wide variety of ontologies, it has not stressed metaphysics in the traditional Western sense. Some ontological questions Chinese philosophers have considered are these: What is reality composed of? Is reality a single type of thing (monism), two types of things (dualism, such as minds and bodies; matter and spirit), or many kinds of things (pluralism)? Is reality composed only of transient things in constant change or are there eternal substances that form its content? Is reality actually as it appears to us, or is it something different than what we think it is? Is reality teleological; that is, is it “purposing” or going toward an end? Is the process of reality guided by a mind or intelligence to occur as it does, or does it follow some internal pattern of its own nature, or do humans attach meaning or purpose to a reality that is devoid of any inherent meaning?

a. Formation of the Early Chinese Worldview

In the period from the beginning of the Zhou dynasty (c. 1045 B.C.E.) to the beginning of the Han dynasty (206 B.C.E.), a number of classical Chinese texts were compiled. These are known now as the “Five Classics” (wujing), and they became enshrined as texts in the educational system of China for hundreds of years. In their received form, all of them have composite elements and some may well reflect the concerns and contexts of later (more in the Han dynasty period) rather than earlier (more in the Zhou dynasty) periods. Despite the uncertain dating of many passages and themes, these texts contain a substantial amount of material that is traceable to the pre-Qin (pre-221 B.C.E.) period, even reaching back to Confucius’s era (551-479 B.C.E.) or before.

The ontology of early Chinese thought comes down to us through a number of philosophical texts which are not traceable to any single author. Included among these are: the “Great Commentary” to the Classic of Changes (Yijing), the Chronicles of Zuo (Zuozhuan), and the “Great Plan” (Hong Fan) section of the Classic of History (Shujing).

i. The Classic of Changes (Yijing) and Its Place in Chinese Philosophy

The Classic of Changes (Yijing) is a complete edited work in two parts. One part is a manual of divination known simply as the Changes (Yi), or more correctly, as the Zhouyi. It is a handbook traceable to the period and practices of the Western Zhou dynasty as indicated, among other features, by its use of language expressions found on the bronzes of that period (c. 1046-771 B.C.E.). The other part of the Classic of Changes is a set of seven commentaries. Three of the commentaries are composed of two sections each. Taken as a whole, the commentary of this second part is known as “The Ten Wings” (Shiyi).

One of the commentaries is known as the Great Commentary (Dazhuan). It is arguably the most important text to study for an understanding of early Chinese ontology. The Classic of Changes as a whole is much less valuable for this purpose.

Regrettably, a determinable date for the composition of the Great Commentary cannot be fixed. However, a version of it was discovered as a silk manuscript among the archaeological finds at the Mawangdui tomb site in Changsha in 1973. Therefore, it must be older than 168 B.C.E. when the tomb was closed. The work makes use of the fundamental philosophical vocabulary of Chinese ontology that continues to be used by Chinese thinkers up to the early modern period. It speaks of Heaven (tian) and earth (di) collectively (tiandi) as a way of talking about “reality”. As for the process of reality’s change, it employs the term dao as a nominative and portrays it as operating according patterns (tian wen) or Principle(s) (li). In this commentary, the substance of reality (qi) is capable of transforming into a myriad of experienced objects, evidencing properties of what might be called in the West “matter” or in other forms “spirit.” Qi is moved by pushes and pulls of its internal opposing forces, yin and yang (Great Commentary Part I, 1, 4). Although reality’s changes are not arbitrary, neither are they guided by a mind or divine intellect. The Great Commentary associates the patterns (li) that give order to reality with the hexagrams found in the divination manual (the Zhouyi). The general philosophical term for the process of reality is “correlative ontology”. Various correlations are possible; for example, yin and yang may be mutually supportive, or one may be transforming the other, balancing it, compensating for it, enhancing it, or furthering something new in relation to the other.

In Western philosophy, the characteristic approach to ontology is to think of things that compose reality as “natural kinds,” each of which has a different essence that makes it what it is; for example, the essence of a chair, a cat, a tree, and so forth. This defining essence is typically called “the nature” of the object. In early Chinese ontology, change and process are more fundamental than continuity and endurance, even if there is sufficient constancy to speak of objects through time. The characteristic configuration of qi that something is actualizing (dao-ing) sets it apart from other things. This distinctive correlation of yin and yang does the philosophical work of the Western concept of essence. It enables identification of kinds and categories of things, without recourse to an ontology in which there is a pluralism of essentially different sorts of substances.

Chinese philosophers inheriting the ontology of the Yijing and Great Commentary still use the concept of the “nature” (xing) of something, but “nature” does not refer to some underlying essence or immaterial substance that makes something what it is in distinction from other things. “Nature” is a way of talking about the manner of qi correlation that actualizes a thing as it is and sets it apart from the correlations of other things.

ii. The Chronicles of Zuo (Zuozhuan, c. 389 B.C.E.)

The Chronicles of Zuo is a record of occurrences of the Spring and Autumn Period (771-468 B.C.E.) that traditionally has been ascribed to Zuo Qiuming, a court writer who lived in the State of Lu during the time of Confucius. The text is arranged as comments on the reign of various Marquis and Dukes and it was likely completed no later than 389 B.C.E.

Remarking on the 7^th year of the reign of Duke Wen (626-609 B.C.E.) the Chronicles of Zuo says: “Water, fire, metal, wood, earth, and grains are called the six natural resources (liu fu, or “six treasures”)”. The character fu is used to denote them. This list of six contains the five phasal elements (wuxing) of wood (mu), fire (huo), earth (tu), metal (jin), and water (shui). We see these in later ontological works but with the addition of the grains. The wuxing correlative ontology refers to a conceptual scheme that is found in traditional Chinese thought. Its elements are regarded as dynamic, interdependent modes or aspects of the universe’s ongoing existence and development. All objects of reality are some combination and in interdependent operation of these five. In comments on the 27^th year of the reign of Duke Xiang (590-573 B.C.E.) the text says: “Heaven has given birth to the five materials (wu cai) which supply humankind’s requirements, and the people use them all. Not one of them can be dispensed with.”

iii. The “Great Plan” in the Classic of History (Shujing)

In the “Great Plan” chapter of the Classic of History the compilers are interested in explaining how society should follow the patterns (li) of Heaven and earth. To do so, they provide the reader with information about these patterns, which offers substantial content about the ontology of the period. For example, in speaking of the nine divisions of the “Great Plan” by which Heaven orders reality, the text refers to the five phasal elements that are the building blocks for all real objects (Classic of History, “Great Plan” 2.2). The chapter does not spell out how the interdependencies of these five phases work, it only says they exist. It is made clear, though, that if humans do not behave in the proper manner, they can disrupt the harmonious operation of these phases, illness and weakness will arise in the body, and disorder will show up in nature and the human world of history.

b. Mozi, (fl. 470-391 B.C.E.)

While a study of Mozi’s (Mo Di or Master Mo) moral thought is paramount to understanding Chinese philosophy, his views on ontology, especially as they are set out in Books 8-37 and 46-49 of the Mozi, are sometimes overlooked. An understanding of Mozi’s views on reality begins with what he has to say about Heaven (tian). In classical Chinese, the word tian has many uses. When used as “Heaven and earth,” it is typically a reference to reality or all that is. Tian used alone is a nominative for the sky or a more or less numinous person.

Not surprisingly, then, the Mozi text often describes Heaven as though it is an agent that acts with intentions (yi, zhi) and desires (yu) (for example, in chapters 26-28). Heaven is praised as impartial, generous, wise, and just. It cares for humans and benefits the worthy by providing resources and blessings. Heaven has a dao that orders all things, including its relations with humanity. To use a comparable philosophical concept from the West for Mozi would be to say that Heaven is providential. Moreover, the source of a universal morality that overcomes and corrects human ethical conceptions is Heaven’s will mediated through the ruler.

Holding such a view is one of the reasons why Mozi is committed to a rejection of the philosophical position that the happenings in the course of reality’s process are predestined or fated (ming). Mozi’s arguments on this subject are gathered in the “Against Fate” chapters (35-37) of his text. A principal argument used by Mozi against the position that reality is fated is a pragmatic one. He holds that accepting such a position would mean that one’s status, health, wealth, success, and longevity are already determined and not consequences of one’s effort or choices in life. Taking this view would lead to disaster (37.10). In fact, Mozi says the concept of fate should be regarded as a creation of evil kings and peasant farmers. His point is that some kings used this philosophical idea as a means to justify their positions of power and wealth, while the peasants used it to explain why their reduced situation in life was not a result of living wrongly, or failing to better themselves; that is, it was fated that they be poor. This explains in part why Mozi considered the ontological concept of ming (fate) to be one a philosopher must reject.

c. Lao-Zhuang Daoist Ontology (c. 350-139 B.C.E.)

To speak collectively of “Lao-Zhuang” tradition is to identify a set of philosophical sentiments and positions in common between the two classical works of emergent Daoism in Chinese intellectual history: the Daodejing (DDJ) and the Zhuangzi (ZZ). Both the Daodejing associated with Laozi and the Zhuangzi ascribed to Zhuang Zhou (369-289 B.C.E.) are composite works not written by a single author. Throughout the classical period, there were many lineages of teachers and disciples, as well as multiple oral and written versions of transmitted materials that came together to form these texts. There was no unified, coherent school called Daoism in the classical period, but the term Lao-Zhuang can be used to capture the family resemblances between lineages and their transmitted teachings.

We have already noticed in our survey of the earliest Chinese ontologies that reality (that is, “Heaven and earth”) is a constant process, but the changes are not haphazard. The Chinese term used to capture the order reality exhibits is dao, which literally means the ‘way’ or ‘path’ that the changing process of reality displays. In this process, there are patterns and principles that are evident to one who reflects on the dao. The dao of qi (the energy which composes all things) gives rise to itself and to forces that move it. It is self-moving, according to the dynamic energies of yin and yang.

The term dao is one of the most important concepts in the Daodejing. Sometimes it is used as a noun (“the Dao”) and other times as a verb (“dao-ing”). According to the Daodejing, the dao has a power in itself from which all things have come (DDJ 42). There is a confidence expressed in the text that the process of the dao of reality is at a minimum benign (DDJ, 37 says dao leaves nothing undone). In fact, it is untangling knots that humans create, as well as blunting the sharp edges constructed by those who are resisting or moving contrary to dao. There is a very close association of dao with Heaven (tian) that benefits and does not harm (DDJ 73, 77, 81). When we look closely at the Daodejing’s remarks about Heaven they make it clear that a critical move is made in Chinese ontology by thinkers in this tradition. Heaven’s dao is life-furthering and full of benefit, but is are without deliberation or plan. Still, unlike the Mozi’s Heaven, dao has no mind: It is not planning or working by a design toward a goal it is trying to reach. It is acting spontaneously, but neither is it leaving loose ends or causing problems, disorder, or confusion.

In the sections of the Zhuangzi anthology that come from the master teacher, Zhuang Zhou, these matters are expressed in a very literary way. For dao the text often uses “The Great Clod” by which all things come into being (ZZ Ch. 2). But when using dao, the Zhuangzi says it lacks form but is its own root, and it gave birth to Heaven and earth and all things (ZZ Ch. 6).

The point being made in both the Daodejing and Zhuangzi is the dao is beyond language and cognitive categories of space and time. It is not in any space nor has it any temporal description. As such dao functions as what philosophers call a “limiting concept”. Asking when dao began serves no purpose because time does not apply to it; neither does speculating about where it exists because it is not in any particular place.

The Zhuangzi does not make any specific reference to the five phasal elements ontology used in the “Great Plan” probably because it was in development at the same time that Zhuangzi text was being formed. It makes clear, however, that all things are changing and being transformed, and that people can have some involvement in their own transformations (ZZ Ch. 6, 7).

d. Correlative Cosmologies in the Han Period: Yinyang and Wuxing Heuristics

According to Sima Tan (d. 110 B.C.E.), during the Spring and Autumn and Warring States (403-221 B.C.E.) periods a school existed that bore the name yinyang. He lists this yinyang school alongside others such as the Confucian, Mohist, Legalist, and Daoist. According to him, this school focused on divination and explored the patterns of Heaven and earth. This school almost certainly had its antecedents in the Zhouyi and was likely a theoretical and heuristic extension of many of the practices associated with that text.

By the Han dynasty (202 B.C.E.-220 C.E.), yinyang thought was associated with the standardization of wuxing (the five phasal elements) correlative cosmology associated with the work of Zou Yan (c. 305-240 B.C.E.). The synthesis of Confucianism, yinyang, and wuxing explanatory philosophies is evident in the writings of the scholar Dong Zhongshu (179-104 B.C.E.) and exhibited in his volume, Luxuriant Dew of the Spring and Autumn Annals (Chunqiu fanlu). The Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi) is also a primary representative text for correlative cosmology. Large sections of Chapters 2, 3, 7, and 20 depend heavily on this ontology for the cogency of the work’s argument about Heaven’s relation to human activity. Masters of Huainan, however, tends to blend Daoist sensibilities (especially Yellow-Emperor Daoist ideas) with yinyang and wuxing more prominently than did Dong Zhongshu’s work.

e. Selected Buddhist Ontologies

Scholars have debated two interpretations of how Buddhist missionaries first reached China in its southern regions: first, through maritime landings that spread up the Chang Jiang (Yangtze River) and the Huai waterway into the area of present day Jiangsu province under Prince Ying of Chu (c. 65 C.E.); and second, by moving overland along the northern Silk Road through the areas controlled by the Yuezhi central Asian peoples in what is now Xinjiang province and western Gansu province. The latter interpretation continues to have the greatest preponderance of evidence in its favor, along with long-standing traditions that the White Horse Temple in the Han capital of Luoyang (present day Henan province) was the first temple in China (c. 68 C.E.). However, it seems clear that Buddhism came into China by both routes.

China did not escape the diversity of Buddhist Madhyamika philosophical schools; many scholars have argued convincingly that Chinese thinkers did not realize for decades that the Buddhist texts coming from India represented different schools of thought and so they tried unsuccessfully to harmonize them into a single philosophical system. Gradually, Chinese thinkers created some distinctively Chinese approaches to and versions of the Buddhist schools and even began some schools that were indigenous to China.

i. Tiantai Buddhism (Zhiyi, 538-597 C.E.)

Unlike earlier schools of Chinese Buddhism, the Tiantai School was largely of Chinese origin. Tiantai flourished under its fourth patriarch, Zhiyi, who asserted that the Lotus Sutra (Fahua jing) contained the supreme teaching of Buddhism. The school derives its name from the Tiantai mountain that served as its base. The most distinctive ontological claim of Tiantai is that there is only one reality that is both the phenomenal existence of everyday experience and nirvana itself. This is a significant divergence from many early Buddhist teachings in India that drew a sharp demarcation between the phenomenal world and the world of nirvana. In Tiantai, there is not only one reality but also it is ultimately empty. The reason all things are empty is that literally every object and real thing (that is, every dharma) exists as it is through an indefinite number of interdependent causes. Nothing has its own nature or essence that underlies or exists apart from the interplay of all these causes. Accordingly, all things have only tentative existence, and they are impermanent.

Humans experience phenomenal reality as various forms of pain and suffering, happiness and contentment, and may also realize overwhelming enlightenment and peace. In fact, Tiantai writings describe ten ways of existing in reality, but these do not reflect any interest in the kinds of extrapolations offered in the other Chinese ontologies, such as dao, yin and yang, or the elaborate five phasal elements system.

The Ten Ways of Existing in Reality According to Tiantai Buddhism1. Hell Beings2. Hungry Ghosts3. Beasts (non-human animals)4. Asuras (demons)5. Human Beings

6. Gods or celestial creatures

7. Voice-hearers (Skravakas)

8. Self-enlightened Ones (Pratyekabuddhas)

9. Bodhisattvas

10. Buddhas

In Tiantai ontology, the reality that Hell Beings inhabit is the same reality in which the Buddhas live. There is no supernatural boundary between these ways of existing; nor are there opposing spiritual realms such as Heaven and Hell. Living and working next to us may be one who is a Hell Being, or a Bodhisattva, or even a Buddha. The goal is not to depart this world and go into some other transcendent reality. It is to exist as a Buddha in this world. There is no other reality except this one; reality is one.

In Tiantai, every human has the capacity to live in reality as a Buddha. Living as such does not make one eternal; every existing thing will be extinct in the form in which it now exists. This is a reflection of the empty nature of reality; the only reality that there is. At the same time, Tiantai does not deny physical reality; it is no Idealism. Rather, it is a form of ontological Realism, confident that manifold concrete yet fundamentally empty things exist, but they may realize sublimity in this life.

ii. Consciousness-only Buddhism (Weishi Zong)

The version of Chinese Buddhism known as Consciousness-only was called Yogacara in India. The monk Xuanzang (c. 602–664), born Chen Hui, was principally responsible for its popularization in China through his translations of texts he brought from India. His travels there are recorded in detail in the classic Chinese text Great Tang Records on the Western Regions, which in turn provided the inspiration for the imaginative spiritual journey novel Journey to the West, written by Wu Cheng’en during the Ming dynasty (1368-1644), around nine centuries after Xuanzang’s death.

The central ontological tenet of Consciousness-only Buddhism is that nothing exists except consciousness. Reality is the flow of experiences and awareness of ideas is called perception. Perceptions are not caused by things external to humans such as concrete or material objects that continue whether humans are conscious of them or not. In ontological language, this is called Idealism, which contrasts with the Realism of Tiantai. In its original context in India, the Consciousness-only teachings were direct contradictions to the prevailing Indian physics of reality that all things (dharmas) are constructed from the atoms of earth, water, fire and air. It also stood in radical contrast to Chinese thought about qi and the five phases.

In Consciousness-only teaching, when a person is born, thereby becoming conscious, individual experience is not funded by encounters with objects in an external world but by something Xuanzang called the “storehouse consciousness”. Every deed that has ever been done and every idea that anyone has had is contained in this consciousness. No dharma (experienced idea) exists by itself, and any alteration in the way other ideas cause it to exist would be a different experience entirely. This is what is meant by the concept of “dependent co-arising” in Consciousness-only philosophy.

Still, not all consciousness is of the same level of development; some forms are higher than others. As the levels of consciousness advance, they “perfume” the highest level of consciousness into being. “Perfuming” in this philosophy is a unique ontological approach to causality, quite different from Aristotle’s discussions of cause and John Stuart Mill’s remarks on the determination of cause.

f. The Neo-Confucian Synthesis of Zhu Xi (1130-1200)

Beginning in the early 11^th century, a group of interdependent philosophers began to reconstruct Chinese philosophy by using a new grammar. They sought to merge Confucian thought with Daoist and Buddhist concepts. While they surely thought of themselves as Confucian, and valorized Confucius and Mencius (c. 372-289 B.C.E.) in their writings, it is clear that they were doing something novel with their appropriation of classical Confucian ideas. Accordingly, they are grouped together as “Neo-Confucians”. This family of thought included philosophers such as Zhang Zai (1020-1077), Cheng Hao (1032-1085), and Cheng Yi (1033-1107).

Without doubt, Zhu Xi is the most influential of these thinkers. His philosophy set the parameters of philosophical conversation on ontology throughout East Asia for over 400 years. Western philosophers of the same stature would include Aristotle in the Classical period, Thomas Aquinas in the Medieval period, and Immanuel Kant in the Enlightenment period. Zhu Xi’s systematization of the Confucian Way (dao) also became a coherent program of education for centuries in China, Korea, and Japan.

Zhu Xi’s extensive philosophical work rests on the foundation of his theory of reality. The place to begin understanding his ontology is in Xi’s following statement: “Everything that has shape and form is “concrete existence” qi. That which constitutes the Principle(s) (li) of “concrete existence” is the Way (dao)” (Collected Writings of Chu Hsi 36.14).

Several philosophical questions arise in Zhu Xi’s ontology. Did he think of Principle(s) as singular or plural? What should be included in Principle(s) when he uses this as an ontological concept? Does Principle(s) refer to something like the logical scaffolding of reality (that is, its design, order, logical structure, or pattern)? Does Zhu Xi use Principle(s) to mean something like the natural laws discoverable by chemistry, physics, and the like? Are Principle(s) in Zhu’s ontology similar to what Kant called the “categories of the mind” (causality, space, time, and so forth). Does Principle(s) sometimes mean “moral principles or norms” that are universally binding and true for all persons? Zhu Xi sometimes uses Principle(s) in one of these senses and sometimes in another. It is not possible to reduce his remarks on Principle(s) to any one of these exclusively. Likewise, the term is sometimes used in a singular and sometimes as a plural in his writings.

For Zhu Xi, the Principle(s) of reality reside in the Supreme Ultimate. But this is not a thing or a being. Rather, before shapes and things began to exist, the Supreme Ultimate from which they came had the principles of shape and order, but was not itself any shape or form. Neither is it a “blank” (wu). It cannot be said to exist (yu) as one thing alongside others. It existed before Heaven and earth. Although the noted scholar Feng Youlan takes Zhu Xi’s discussion of Principle(s) to be a version of what Plato called the Forms (see his A Short History of Chinese Philosophy), such a reading is arguable. It is not as though a brick is an expression of the Platonic Form of a brick. Rather, a brick is the result of a specific five-phase configuration ‘bricking’ (as a verb of action) according to Principle(s) that are universally shared by all things. The Supreme Ultimate is a concept used for talking collectively about the Principle(s) governing the five phases and yin and yang. On this reading, Principle(s) enable concrete configurations of qi to yield the myriad things that furnish reality.

Zhu Xi’s ontology may be considered a form of Naturalism, rather than Theism. The Supreme Ultimate is not God in the Western sense or Plato’s Form of the Good. However, neither is it reducible to or the product of the other cosmological operators in Zhu’s thought such as qi, yin, yang, or the five phases.

g. Wang Yangming (1472-1529)

The principal sources for Wang Yangming’s ideas are his Instructions for Practical Living (Chuan Xilu, 1518) and “Inquiry on the Great Learning” (1527). The latter work offers a succinct summary of the main themes he developed throughout his life.

Wang is often understood to be an ontological Idealist. But he makes it clear that he is not an Idealist in a famous story where he points out to a friend the flowering trees on a cliff. The friend assumes that Wang’s position is a form of Idealism. He then challenges Wang by claiming the flowers are independent from his mind. Wang’s reply makes his ontology clear. He says that before the friend looked at the flowering trees, they were simply there in their vacancy, but when the friend experiences them, he thinks of them as a tree, a cliff, and flowers. Thus, as the experienced “world” they are not at all independent of his friend’s mind. They cannot be “flowers on a cliff” without the mind.

Why is this? For Wang, the reason is very clear. It is because human minds are inherently patterning. Known as the Human minds Principle (li), this patterning that makes things as they are into a universe or reality. Otherwise, there are only concrete things (qi) moving around; there is really no “world”. So, Wang is not denying the existence of concrete things as in Idealism but he is insisting that these things are not without the patterning that the mind brings to experience.

When human minds do this patterning it is not always a conscious or deliberative process. Likewise, individuals also do not “know” the Principles by which they engage in the process. Rather, in the most truthful experiences, human minds are one with Heaven and earth, and the Principles are applied directly by “pure intelligence” (liangzhi), not through the mediation of data from the five senses, or by discursive reason, or the authority of any book or philosophical teacher.

There is a fundamental difference, though, between Wang’s position and that of Zhu Xi. Wang does not set Principle(s) in a transcendent sense apart from concrete things. In fact, he gives them no existence apart from the human mind. If there were no human mind, there would be no “world.”

h. Shifting Paradigms in Chinese Ontology

i. Dai Zhen (1723-1777)

Dai Zhen’s two most prominent philosophical works are entitled On the Good (Yuanshan) and An Evidential Study of the Meaning and Terms of the Mencius (Mengzi ziyi shuzheng). Some interpreters hold that Dai Zhen was responsible for a major paradigm shift in Chinese thinking on ontology. He completely removed the transcendent aspect from Principle(s) (li), and this is certainly a shift from Zhu’s understanding. Furthermore, Dai did not think that Principle(s) were independent of concrete things as Zhu did, but neither did he think they were an activity of the human mind as Wang believed. Instead, he conceived of Principle(s) as the internal order (tiao) or pattern (wen) of things-in-themselves.

To use Western philosophical terms, Dai’s thinking is as a form of teleological naturalism. Purpose, pattern, and design are not imposed on reality by human beings, but neither do they derive from a transcendent realm that is wholly other than the natural process itself. Instead, they are a part of the very nature of the stuff of reality itself.

Some interpreters of Dai characterize his position by means of a rather distinctive Chinese example. A method used to determine the authenticity of a piece of jade in China is to hold it up to the light and observe whether veins can be seen in its translucence. If so, the jade is authentic. If not, it is an imitation and a fake. Accordingly, Dai may be interpreted to be saying that concrete objects have such analogous striations and these are the Principle(s) that give order to reality.

ii. Hu Shi (1891-1962)

Hu Shi was a key figure in the New Culture Movement that introduced ideas from the West to China. This movement developed the slogans “Mr. Science” and “Mr. Democracy” to describe Western learning (Xi xue). Hu specifically acknowledged the influence of Thomas Huxley and John Dewey on his thought, and he was a contemporary with some of the most prominent Western philosophers, including Ludwig Wittgenstein and Martin Heidegger. He has been called the central figure in 20^th century Chinese academic thought.

Hu studied in a Western-style system in Shanghai, being particularly impressed by the Darwinian theory of evolution. Later, he studied in America at Cornell and Columbia University, where John Dewey became his dissertation supervisor. While still a young student in Shanghai, he summarized the changes in his conception of life in the universe from the Chinese ontology with which he was raised. Published in 1923, he entitled this summary the “New Credo”. Its includes the following points:

On the basis of knowledge of astronomy and physics, people should recognize that the world of space is infinitely large.
On the basis of geological and paleontological knowledge, people should recognize that the universe extends over infinite time.
On the basis of all verifiable scientific knowledge, people should recognize that the universe and everything in it follow natural laws of movements in change. So, what is “natural” is the Chinese sense of “being so of its self” and there is no need for the concept of a supernatural Ruler or Creator.
On the basis of the biological sciences, people should recognize the terrific wastefulness and brutality in the struggle for existence in the biological world and consequently the untenability of the hypothesis of a benevolent Ruler.
On the basis of the biological, physiological, and psychological sciences, people should recognize that man is only one species in the animal kingdom that differs from the other species only in degree, but not in kind.
On the basis of the knowledge derived from anthropology, sociology, and the biological sciences, people should understand the history and causes of the evolution of living organisms and of human society.
On the basis of the biological and psychological sciences, people should recognize that all psychological phenomena could be explained through the law of causality.
On the basis of biological and historical knowledge, people should recognize that morality and religion are subject to change and that the causes of such change can be scientifically studied.
On the basis of newer knowledge of physics and chemistry, people should recognize that matter is full of motion and not static.
On the basis of biological, sociological, and historical knowledge, people should recognize that the individual self is subject to death and decay. But the sum total of individual achievement, for better or for worse, lives on in the immortality of the Larger Self. That to live for the sake of the species and posterity is religion of the highest kind; and that those religions that seek a future life either in Heaven or in the Pure Land are selfish religions.

Hu Shi calls this credo “The Naturalistic Conception of Life and the Universe”. This work, which he saw as a turn from Chinese philosophy leading up to the 20^th century, illustrates his commitment to the experimental sciences. He continued to embrace this credo throughout his life.

2. Epistemology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Scope of Knowledge

Some epistemological questions are these: What is it “to know”? Can we know something to be true, or do we only believe things to be true (skepticism)? Are all knowledge claims of the same sort? Are they justified in the same way? What are the tools we use to know something (reason, senses, direct apprehension, and so forth)? Do we possess innate knowledge? Is there a limit to what we can know?

a. The Mozi, Later Mohists and Debaters (bianshi)

In his rejection of the commonly held belief that reality is fated (ming), Mozi’s students asked him to set out the philosophical bases for knowing how to judge between views. In general, the response he makes to this question serves as a reasonable outline for his theory of how to establish a claim’s truth. He insists that knowledge must be pursued by means of three criteria (Mozi 35.5). Mozi’s first test for judging between knowledge claims is what we may call an examination of the received belief about the claim. This is understood as what the historical records report. The second truth test is what Mozi calls “the evidence of the eyes and ears of the common people”. He takes this to mean direct experiential testimony to the truth of a claim. His third test for determining truth is that the truth of a claim rests on observing whether acting on the claim yields the expected results, which should obtain if it is true.

Applying these three criteria leads Mozi to accept the claim that ghosts and spirits exist. He argues that received knowledge includes the intervention and existence of spirits as explanatory devices and that there is widespread testimony to the presence of such phenomena. Most importantly, however, Mozi feels that the pragmatic implications of giving up such a belief would be disastrous; cruelty, robbery, and warfare, for Mozi, are common precisely because people have come to doubt whether ghosts and spirits exist or not. He says, “If all the people of the world could be brought to believe that ghosts and spirits are able to reward the worthy and punish the wicked, then how could the world be in disorder?” (Mozi 31.1)

Mozi’s students, and their students, developed his interest in how we know something to be true in the years following his life. In Records of the Grand Historian, Sima Tan (d. 110 B.C.E.) identified a group of thinkers he called Mingjia (名家, School of Names). These thinkers have been variously classified as debaters, rhetoricians, dialecticians, logicians, and skeptics. In the Warring States Period (c. 475-221 B.C.E.), however, the name used more generally for thinkers occupied with such epistemological questions was bianshi 辯士 (often rendered as “disputers” or “rhetoricians”). The approaches and arguments of the bianshi can be associated with the work of the so-called Later Mohist philosophers. We know this group of thinkers largely through the final six chapters of the Mozi text (Chapters 40-45), which form an entirely different unit than the earlier sections of the work.

Outside the Mozi text, the ideas of two of the bianshi are known to us through sources which we may have some degree of confidence: Hui Shi (307?-210? B.C.E.) and Gongsun Longzi (b. 380? B.C.E.). Hui Shi shows up in nine chapters of the Zhuangzi. The text Gongsun Longzi is attributed to Gongsun Long. (For an English translation see Mei Yi-Pao (1953)). It is nearly certain that later bianshi would not have accepted Mozi’s position that ghost and spirits exist.

b. Lao-Zhuang Traditions on Knowing and Truth

There is much in the Lao-Zhuang tradition that seems to suggest anti-intellectualism and anti-rationalism. It is said that sages make sure the people are without knowledge (DDJ 3), those who pursue the dao are cautioned to abandon learning (DDJ 20), states are said to be difficult to rule because the people “know too much” (DDJ 65), and the knowledgeable are contrasted unfavorably with the enlightened (DDJ 33). Moreover, wuwei as a distinctive form of conduct is a teaching without words (DDJ 43) and comes through an experience of numinal vision and confirmation (DDJ 10). However, these passages do not set out a form of anti-intellectualism. Interpreted in their context, they are part of the Lao-Zhuang insistence that the distinctions and concepts by which reason works are of human design, which may mislead people about the nature of reality or tangle them in problems they create themselves. Reason, evidence and argument have their place, but they do not extend to the fullness of freedom and happiness achieved in following the dao.

The Zhuangzi, too, seems opposed to critical inquiry and application of reason and logic. People are cautioned not to wear out their brains with distinctions (ZZ ch. 2). The text uses many examples to point out that what a person thinks he knows is really relative to context and not absolute, and what a person knows is nothing compared to what he does not know (ZZ ch. 17). People are warned that skillfulness in argument culminating in “winning” the point is not equivalent to arriving at truth (ZZ ch. 2). Rhetoricians and logicians are compared to nimble monkeys and rat-catching dogs (ZZ ch. 12). They are skillful at rational gymnastics, but poor at realizing truth. Instead, truth comes through stillness, emptying oneself of rational and human distinctions (that is, naturalness) and direct receptivity of the presence of dao (ZZ ch. 21). For all the affection and friendship between them, Zhuangzi did not approve of the bianshi thinker Hui Shi’s approach to knowledge.

In this tradition, the power to master life and the ability to control one’s transformation is not an achievement of reason. This is not the same as saying that the Lao-Zhuang teachers had no use for reason and sense evidence. Truth comes from oneness with dao. When realized, one flows in life spontaneously and effortlessly, without thought, just like the famous butcher of the Inner Chapters, Cook Ding, who cuts up an ox without ever hitting a bone or dulling his knife (ZZ ch. 3).

c. Mencius (Mengzi, c. 372-289 B.C.E.) and Analogical Reasoning

Although it is often said that classical Chinese philosophers did not place a premium on argumentation, Mencius was a master of the use and criticism of analogical argument. This was the most prevalent method of approaching knowledge and establishing truth among 4^th century B.C.E. Chinese thinkers. Mencius often used this method in his criticisms of other philosophers such as Mozi, Gaozi, and Yangzi.

Analogical reasoning in this period included both the use of one thing to throw light on another and the use of one proposition known to be true to throw light on another of similar form, the truth of which was undetermined. Two advantages of this form of argument in the classical period have been identified. One is that an analogy is often as valuable epistemologically when it breaks down as when it works. The second is that analogy is often the only tool available for exploring a subject that is obscure or one that eludes direct experience. Mencius and his interlocutors carry on their debates in the Mengzi largely through the method of analogy.

One example of Mencius’s use of analogy is his famous exchange with Gaozi recorded in the Mengzi 6A2. In this passage, Gaozi criticizes Mencius’s view that human nature has an inborn tendency to seek goodness by saying that human nature is like water; it will seek whatever outlet is available, showing no preference for flowing East or West. While accepting the analogy between human nature and water, Mencius reminds Gaozi that although water does not prefer East to West, it most surely has the nature to flow downhill, rather than uphill. Likewise, Mencius concludes, human nature has the propensity to move toward the good, just as water seeks downhill.

d. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): Dispelling Obsessions

According to Sima Qian, Xunzi was once the leader of the Jixia Academy, a site where thinkers of the 100 schools (baijia) were represented. Xunzi made skillful appeals to both empirical and rational sources as necessary for arriving at knowledge. Yet, he held that discursive reason could not resolve quandaries if it excluded feeling and emotion, appealing to xin (heart-mind) as an arbiter of truth whenever it operated in a clear state (da qingming), setting aside presuppositions and amok emotion. To prevent such confusions in understanding, Xunzi turned to the concept of fa, meaning “criterion” or “standard”. He held that reasoning, whether analytically making distinctions or synthesizing diverse positions, operates by rules that approximate the way in which a geometer might judge a circle by using a compass. To know something is to be guided by these standards of reasoning to a conclusion. In Chapters 21and 22 of Xunzi, he says the heart-mind draws distinctions among reasons, explanations, and desires similarly to how the eye draws distinctions among colors. Xunzi insists that we never cease learning and investigating. It is just such cumulative knowledge that can save us from obsessions and superstitions, leading us to focus instead on activities that will create a more humane world.

e. Wang Chong (c. 25-100 C.E.): Critical Chinese Philosophy in the Classical Period

Wang Chong was a critic of many received views on ontology, morality, religion, and politics. His writings on these subjects were compiled into the work entitled Critical Essays (Lunheng). It reveals Wang’s critical and somewhat skeptical mind at work, and also his flair for originality in approaching philosophical problems at the end of the period of classical Chinese philosophy. Speaking of his own work, he says, “Although the chapters of my Critical Essays may only number in the tens, one phrase likewise covers them all, namely, ‘hatred of fictions and falsehoods’” (Critical Essays ch. 61).

Wang is keenly aware of the tensions between empirical and rational pursuits of truth, and he insists both must play a role in the advance of knowledge. One cannot depend only on experience because it can be deceptive; thus reason (xinyi) must be involved. He says bluntly that the Mohists did not use their minds to verify things, but indiscriminately believed what common people reported to have experienced. Thereby, the Mohists fell into deception (ch. 67). Moreover, against the Daoists he holds that history never affords any instances of men knowing what is true without inquiry and reasoning (ch. 2). However, Wang is also aware that one could make a coherent set of premises into a logical argument that nevertheless would contradict ordinary and uniform experience and thus be untrue.

In his practice of testing differing positions and claims, Wang often uses the method known in Chinese as “arguing from a lodging place”. This is similar to the strategy of assuming an opponent’s position “for the sake of argument”. Wang believes that by adopting this tactic he can most easily reveal the logical flaws or evidential weaknesses of a position he thinks is false. He frequently makes use of the reductio ad absurdum technique; that is, he shows that an untenable or absurd result follows from accepting the belief in question. His skillfulness in seeing the limitations of both reason and experience as sources for claims he considers weak is one explanation for why early sources, perhaps as a way of ridiculing Wang, wrongly grouped him with the qingtan (“pure talk”) masters, who were skilled rhetoricians and said to be more intent on making arguments rather than gaining truth.

Wang does not believe that all questions can be answered because he insists that one cannot find the truth on the basis of partial evidence alone. Here his approach brings into light the distinction between belief and truth. Many more things can be believed than can be known. Believing something is not “knowing” it. Wang’s use of the term xu as “false” refers to a belief of a certain type. He held that claims shown to be false do not attract us. No one knowingly believes a falsehood. But xu beliefs have not been conclusively falsified and they have attractive features, such as making us feel better about life events, or ourselves, and thus they are difficult to give up believing. Wang’s way of understanding xu helps us to make sense of passages in which he talks as if xu beliefs possess an attractiveness that entices the undisciplined mind.

Wang has no patience with what he considers to be the superstitions of his day, and he does not hesitate to criticize his predecessors, including Confucius, Mozi, Mencius, and those thinkers involved in trying to create a synthesis with the five-phase cosmology and its related belief systems. He uses argument and empirical evidence to criticize the worship of Confucius, to debunk belief in omens, to discount any evidential basis for fengshui, and to show the contradictions in a belief in ghosts and spirits. Wang argues that Heaven (tian) is merely a name for natural physical processes, which are not powers to be assuaged by ritual or prayer. Rather, they are processes to be studied through observation and reason.

f. Tiantai Buddhism’s Threefold Truth Epistemology

The defining thesis of Tiantai is actually epistemological. As advanced by the philosopher Zhiyi, it is the teaching of Threefold Truth (san di), which includes the following points. 1) We can make true statements about the world of ordinary objects. These truths are about things that exist and their interactions in a network of interdependent causes. These are the truths of history, science, and so forth, about provisional existence. 2) It is also true to say that all things are empty (kong di) and have no permanence. Everything in reality is devoid of any self-nature. Of course, it is the realization of this truth that liberates one from suffering because it breaks one’s attachment to things and persons who are the objects of our desires. 3) The mundane or phenomenal world is real, but it is also impermanent and ultimately empty. This is truth as the Middle Way (zhong di).

Zhiyi thought that persons had varying epistemological capabilities, which put them on different levels of knowledge. Some people are only able to grasp truth in its mundane expression. For them, truth enables engagement with the world and its pleasures, desires, and attachments. They suffer because of this, although they may resist desires through moral action, prayer, devotion and the like. Conversely, others express truth as per the Threefold teaching; that is, as emptiness. They detach from the mundane, living apart from it as much as possible. But for those who are capable of it, truth is seen for what it is, and yet they live in the mundane, knowing it is real; but also seeing its emptiness.

g. Wang Yangming on liangzhi: Direct, Clear, Universal Knowledge

Wang Yangming wrote, “What I mean by the investigation of things (gewu) and the extension of knowledge is to apply the pure knowledge (zhi liangzhi) of my mind to each and every thing.” According to Wang, even ordinary knowledge gained by the use of reason requires the direct and clear apprehension of Principle(s) (li) innate to human minds. However, there is also knowledge that cannot be acquired or transmitted by discursive reasoning. He once said to a disciple, “Knowledge acquired through personal realization is different from that acquired through listening to discussion. When I first lectured on the subject, I knew you took it lightly and were not interested. However, when one goes further and realizes this essential and wonderful thing personally to its depth, he will see that it becomes different every day [i.e., in its guiding power] and it is inexhaustible” (Instructions, sec. 11).

According to Wang Yangming’s biography, while exiled in the Guizhou region he experienced a kind of direct enlightenment or pure knowledge (liangzhi) after which he began teaching what he called “the unity of knowledge and action” (zhixing heyi). In liangzhi, one is impelled to act in a certain way. Following this, the person can be said to possess the knowledge of how to act. But there are not two events, one volitional and the other epistemological. The acting is the knowing.

In 20^th century Western philosophy, British thinkers wrote deliberately about the distinction between “knowing that” and “knowing how”. On these terms, Wang Yangming’s notion about the knowledge gained in liangzhi is a third concept, one that has affinities with both epistemology and action. Liangzhi is not a “faculty” of the mind or a special kind of “sense”. Nor is liangzhi the sort of knowledge by which one knows where to dig a well or when to plant crops. One cannot know everything by liangzhi, for example, whether there is evidence of water on Mars. Yet, Wang says that when our heart-mind is operating by liangzhi, a person is moved irresistibly to act freely from all obstruction caused by desires; and within acting lies knowing what to do.

h. Hu Shi (1891-1962): Pragmatism and Experimentalism

When John Dewey arrived in Shanghai on May 1, 1919, the story of Western philosophy’s impact on Chinese thought turned a new page; American Pragmatism’s influence on Chinese intellectual history had begun. Hu Shi claimed that no Western scholar up to that time had exerted the magnitude of Dewey’s influence.

Hu Shi’s contribution to epistemology in Chinese philosophy seems based largely on his adaptation of Dewey’s pragmatism, which Hu preferred to call “experimentalism”. Hu follows Dewey in thinking that the function of the concept of “truth” in the theory of knowledge is instrumental. This means that Hu Shi’s view of truth can be set apart from some other epistemological approaches. He does not think a claim is true if it corresponds to the way the world is; that is, if the claim expresses what humans see, feel, hear, and so forth. Rather, he thinks that saying a claim is true means that the claim may be employed as an instrument to deal with the environment and context of everyday life. True beliefs enable people to deal with life situations effectively and consistently. This means that as life realities change, so might the claims that are “true”. Thus truth is not a minted coin that never changes. He specifically uses this approach to free himself from the views of ancient Chinese sages and their writings, which he feels should be studied largely as historical artifacts and much less so as viable philosophical options.

However, Hu Shi’s view of truth, like Dewey’s, is no mere subjectivism. Instead of truth being something that is relative to the individual, Hu argues that a claim that something is true requires that it be demonstrated experimentally. He has, however, a very broad view of what counts as an experimental demonstration of a claim. By “experimental” he means demonstration according to the scientific method of experiment and confirmation. Yet, he regards this method as only one way of establishing a claim’s effects when it is true or disconfirming the claim when it is false. This way of proceeding has specific implications for his social theory. He thinks that claims being made about economics, politics, morality, and the social sciences can and should be confirmed experimentally by observing whether the observable outcomes of the claim’s being true or false can be confirmed in actual practice.

In the context of Chinese epistemologies, Hu stands out as opposing all kinds of authoritarianism and dogmatism; simply because Confucius or Zhu Xi or some other figure says something, it does not make it true in the current context.

i. Zhang Dongsun (1886-1973): Pluralistic Cultural Epistemology

In the early half of the 20^th century, Zhang Dongsun was one of the most important philosophers in China, especially owing to his efforts to establish, in dialogue with Western philosophy, a unique philosophical epistemology in the Chinese context. This approach has variously been labeled as Pluralistic Epistemology or Cultural Epistemology.

For Zhang, what counts as evidence, what we seek to know, what we think it is possible to know, what we notice through our senses, how we interpret our sense perceptions, and what qualifies as a sufficient reason to say we know something all represent epistemological positions that are inevitably culturally defined and structured. Persons are not merely acculturated to observe festivals, organize themselves socially, or valorize certain heroes. They are also shaped by their cultures to operate epistemologically in different ways.

The most obvious way in which all epistemology can be shown to be cultural is that knowledge is expressed in a particular language. Of course, language is a cultural product. Languages have grammar and structure, and these embody logic and rules for reasoning. For example, Zhang argued that the structure of Western languages leads philosophers to look for the substance underlying the attributes predicated of an object. So, the investigation of the nature of substance itself became one of the central problems of Western philosophy but it did not arise in Chinese philosophy, because the language is differently constructed.

Zhang’s pluralistic cultural epistemology has no room for truth that transcends all cultures, or for the idea that there is a universal criterion for knowledge, such as the correspondence of a proposition to external objects. Knowledge is always mediated through culture. Knowledge and truth are functions of established criteria within a specific cultural epistemology. Further, there is no way to approach “reality” that is free of the cultural constraints determining what one is looking for, what questions one asks, or what is taken as sufficient evidence for a belief.

3. Moral Theory: Fundamental Questions on Morality

Moral theory and ethics are concerned with questions such as these: How should we live? Is the ultimate purpose of our lives to pursue happiness or pleasure, obey moral rules, please others or higher beings, or follow our own interests? Insofar as the origin of our morality, do we invent morality and agree to it, is it inborn or part of our nature, or is it given by a higher being or intelligence? Is something good or right to do depending on the consequences of the action, our duties, or our passionate feelings? Is morality universal, or relative to its culture or the individual? Are the most basic and important things in morality the actions we do or the sort of persons we are? Many of these questions are addressed directly and indirectly throughout the history of Chinese philosophy.

a. Confucius (551-479 B.C.E.): the Exemplary Person Ideal

The first access that most people have into Chinese philosophy in general, and certainly into the thought of Confucius, is through the Analects (Lunyu). This work is an anthology of selected sayings in which Confucius is often the main teacher. When speaking of morality, the term Confucius uses that is perhaps the closest in meaning is li, often translated as the rites that guide conduct. Li refers to the manner of comporting oneself that helps people transcend animality, develop humaneness (ren), and even exceed present ways of being human by raising themselves to higher expression. This expression is captured by the concept of “exemplary person” (junzi).

In the Analects, the humane (ren) person is able to endure hardship and enjoy happy circumstances (4.2), identify good and evil (4.3), and be free from the desire to do wrong (4.4). Being ren comes through self-cultivation and observing li, and it cannot be reduced to the dichotomy often found in Western moral theory between action (doing) and character (being). Confucius recognizes the importance of both what persons do and the sort of person one is. A person of ren character will act in a certain way; the construction of this character cannot occur without doing the li acts derived from and embodied in the lives of persons who have gone before as our exemplars (junzi). Making oneself into such a person is the work of self-cultivation.

There is no single word in the Analects for self-cultivation; but as a concept Confucius teaches, its imprint is present in the earliest stratum of his teachings. In thinking of the dedication and commitment needed for cultivating oneself, Confucius calls on his disciples to give their utmost (zhong) (3.19). Self-cultivation is not simply learning from books; it includes character development, enhancing talents, and refining (wen) one’s humanity itself (5.15). Cultivating oneself into an exemplary person is never merely reduced to one’s moral actions or values. Confucius recognized that in the activity of self-cultivation everyone makes mistakes, but he taught that it is tragic to repeat a mistake or fail to reform after making one (9.25). Confucius thinks of human being development as taking a raw piece of jade and carving and polishing it until it is fully refined (9.13).

Six of Book 4’s analects specifically describe the exemplary person. Such a person always does what is appropriate (yi) (4.10, 16), cherishes moral excellence (de) (4.11), and is not driven by desires (4.10). Exemplary persons take the high road, not the low one (14.23), and they feel ashamed if their high-sounding words are not fully reflected in their deeds (14.27). Indeed, exemplary persons cherish their excellence of character over power, land, or thought of gain. Exemplary persons take as much trouble discovering what is right as lesser men take to learn what will pay (4.16).

Confucius’s teachings on the exemplary person and self-cultivation are the touchstone for the moral and human ideals of Chinese culture down to the present day.

b. Mohist Moral Philosophy

The doctrine of “Inclusive Concern” (jian ai) is the best known of all Mohist teachings. Mozi took the position that in order to achieve social order people must be concerned for each other, showing care for others and not merely for themselves or their own families. This position was used by the later Mohists to criticize what they took to be the Confucian view; namely, that one has moral responsibilities and duties only to those to whom one is related (that is, the Five Relationships of Confucianism—ruler/subject; parent/child; spouse/spouse; elder sibling/younger sibling; and friend/friend). Practically speaking, jian ai meant that in relationships with others, people should seek mutual benefit and express mutual respect.

Mozi understood the chief problem of humanity in its “state of nature” to have been a world of plural moralities and competing values that eventuated in disorder, selfishness, and evil. So, he argued that a coherent social order must rest on a common and coherent morality that is absolutely and universally true. He held that if pluralism of moral values is allowed to exist, conflict would be the inescapable result. Accordingly, two preeminent philosophical questions occupied Mozi. What is the source of true morality? What is the content of true morality?

Mozi praises Heaven (tian) as impartial, generous, wise, just and caring, and regards it as the source for true morality. Heaven cares for humans and benefits the worthy by providing resources and blessings, while judging and punishing the wicked. Heaven has a dao that orders all things, including its relations with humanity.

Mozi finds the reliance on elitist consensus as the source for morality, which he associates with Confucius and the ideal of the exemplary person (junzi), to be both unconvincing and flawed. He takes the view that even if a practice is traditional (for example, received rites such as li) it is not necessarily morally right. He makes a distinction between custom and morality, associating the Confucian li with custom, while advocating objective moral standards coming from Heaven that he calls fa. For such moral norms, the analogy Mozi uses most often is the plumb line or the L-square. He points out that the function of these tools is to guide the performance of work. They are reliable, objective, and even the novice can employ them. The function of Heaven’s standards is to provide an absolute and universal guide for human life.

As for how we know the content of the Heaven’s true morality, it is mediated through the ruler to the layers of hierarchy down to the people. Specifically, Mozi argues that in human society prototypes, exemplars, and role models that exhibit correct judgments and true morality do so because they are following the will of Heaven or the standards (fa) specified by the Son of Heaven (ruler) who perceives and understands the divine source of morality. While following these standards will yield the best and most efficacious results, Mozi is not strictly a utilitarian. He does not say that examining or quantifying the desirable consequences of an action determines moral right or good. Good outcomes result from following Heaven’s Way and represent confirmation that the standard is from Heaven, but the consequences themselves are not the source of morality’s content.

c. Lao-Zhuang Traditions and wuwei

The Daodejing teaches that when individuals try to make something happen in the world by their own reasoning, plans, and contrivances, they inevitably make a mess of it. But if they take their hands off the course of their lives and move with the dao, then it will untangle all life’s knots, blunt its sharp edges, and soften its harsh glare (DDJ 56). This is relevant to an understanding of Lao-Zhuang teachings on morality because moral distinctions are regarded in this tradition as the kind of tampering and “trying to make something happen” that is warned against.

In Chapter 18 of the Daodejing, the ancient masters have transmitted the teaching that it was only when persons abandoned oneness with dao that they begin to make distinctions in morality. The Daodejing makes this point by specifically mentioning in a critical manner several of the distinctions made in Confucian moral and social philosophy: humaneness (ren); appropriateness (yi); filiality (xiao); and kindness (ci) (DDJ 18). If humans had continued in their primal oneness with dao, they would not have needed to invent such moral discriminations. So, in the Lao-Zhuang traditions there is a call to return to human inner nature that moves with the dao and away from the conventions of morality.

In the Zhuangzi, making distinctions of these sorts is considered a disease that is condemned in several logia of the text (ZZ chs. 2, 5). In the Lao-Zhuang traditions, struggling over these human-made distinctions represents the source of all strife in the world. The key is not to begin this process at all or to empty oneself of it by forgetting such distinctions and returning to the unity with dao, expressing its power (de).

For both the Daodejing and Zhuangzi, the concept wuwei is used to report a kind of effortless, spontaneous conduct that invariably expresses moral efficacy without deliberation or calculating consequences. This is not an ability that is available to persons without preparation. A person caught up in making moral distinctions should not expect to be able to wuwei (as a verb) without first entering into oneness with dao by forgetting those very distinctions. As the Daodejing says, “The [persons who possess the] highest de (virtuous power) do not strive for it and so they have it (DDJ ch. 38).

The holiness of wuwei conduct rests on the fact that moving in this manner accords in the situation with an efficacy that can only be attributed to the dao; it could never have resulted from human wisdom, planning, or contrivance. This is not to say that such action might not correspond to conventional human moral belief. Rather, the point is this: While moving in wuwei may look to the outside observer like moral conduct following human distinctions, its origin lies in empty stillness. It is a hopeless pursuit to invert this process and think that by following human morality one will come upon the dao or be able to wuwei.

The Zhuangzi compares the spontaneous and effortless action of wuwei to the kind of prehension Cook Ding experiences when he cuts up an ox without ever hitting a bone or dulling his knife (ZZ ch. 3). Zhuangzi’s disciples also gathered several stories about conduct analogous to wuwei. For example, stories of extraordinary swimmers and divers; the ferryman in the gulf of Shangshen who handled his boat with commensurate skill; the amazing cicada-catching hunchback; Ji Shengzi, the game cock trainer for King Xuan; Bohun Wuren’s skill in archery; Qing, who makes bell stands that seem to be the work of the spirits; and Chui, the artist who can draw free-hand as true as a compass or T-square (ZZ ch. 19).

d. Mencius (c. 372–289 B.C.E.): Morality as Cultivated Human Nature

The Mencius text records Mencius’s position that humans are distinct from other sentient creatures in having a “moral lens” made up of four propensities (siduan). Another way of saying this is that humans moralize in a way analogous to how that a corn kernel yields corn and not tomatoes. Mencius means that humans do not start out as blank slates having to learn to moralize. All humans must learn specific moralities, but they are enabled, and even inclined, to do so because of the four propensities that he calls “seeds”. For Mencius, humans are good by nature. This view marks the beginning of his philosophy of anthropology.

When reading Mencius, the early Chinese ontology that he inherited must be kept in mind. For him, there is no object that is a self or soul as found in Western philosophy. There is no identifiable “humanness” that sets humans apart from animals. Nevertheless, there is a sort of five-phase correlation of qi that has produced a human rather than something else. The four propensities are part of this structure, and they may be stated as follows: One whose heart-mind (xin) is devoid of compassion, shame, courtesy and modesty, and moral discretion is not human (Mencius 2A6).

The fact that Mencius chooses agriculture metaphors when writing about human nature suggests he is being consistent with the early Chinese ontology that influenced him. The Chinese graph for nature (xing) is related to a word meaning “to be born” or “to live/grow” (sheng). Thus, “nature” can refer to the defining characteristics of a thing, but it can also refer to the characteristics of a thing that will develop over the course of time if given a healthy environment.

Chinese philosophy does not insist on a thick understanding of essentialism. Yet, this does not mean that people are born without generally defining propensities. There are inborn, transitive, generational patterns that create bodies. To be devoid of these or possess some other set might eventuate in some other creature, but not a human body. Likewise, for Mencius, anyone devoid of the four propensities of morality lacks a human nature (xing) and cannot become human.

Mencius’s position cannot be falsified by human wrongdoing. He does not mean that humans are innately programmed to be morally good, or that they will automatically grow into morally good beings. The kernel will produce corn, but not if it is deprived of cultivation. Likewise, human nature is predisposed by means of inborn tendencies to act morally, but being morally good is not automatic.

Evil and violent times can retard the youth, just as drought can harm the crops (6A7; 6A9). The great and luxuriant trees of Ox Mountain are beautiful, but if constantly lopped by axes, we cannot be surprised if the mountain appears bald and ugly. The same is true of a person who repeatedly cuts down the sprouts of his moral intuitions and follows a way of immorality (6A8). On the other hand, Mencius thought that the incipient seeds of morality would grow, with cultivation by li, into the humane person (ren).

The cultivation of these seeds enables a person to increase in humaneness (ren) just as a fire that continually builds or a spring that has begun to vent will flow ever more strongly (6A6). Mencius believes a person can, by virtue of cultivating his inborn moral endowments, find a special kind of energy that he calls “flood-like energy” (haoran zhi qi), which brings both delight over one’s decisions and power to continue performing virtue. In taking this approach, Mencius is making the difference between his position and that of Mozi very clear.

e. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): On the Carving and Polishing of the Human Being

Unlike Mencius, Xunzi believes that human nature is disposed to self-interest and that, left alone without moral guidance and the restrictions of law, self-interest will degenerate into selfishness and breed disorder and chaos. Goodness will not grow from within like corn stalks from kernels because human inclinations are not the four propensities Mencius identified, but desires for beautiful sights and sounds, comfort and power. Unless controlled, these and other desires become violence, willful violation of others, and destruction.

Xunzi says that the sage-kings established moral rites, such as discriminations of right and wrong, and li, to shape, guide, and control people. For Xunzi, human beings invented morality; they did not discover it within Heaven (Mencius) or have it disclosed to them by Heaven (Mozi). Accordingly, if the sage-kings had not invented the rites, there would have been no civilization and no order. Subsequent generations must be transformed by the influence of teachers and models, and follow especially the guidance of morality and rituals of human conduct (li) handed down to them.

Humans depend on the rites of morality created over generations by exemplary humans to shape and carve individual being into something worthwhile. A way of extending the importance of this difference between Mencius and Xunzi is to notice the shift in metaphors that Xunzi makes. Where Mencius used agricultural metaphors, Xunzi employed craft analogies: woodworking, jade carving, home construction, and so forth. For Xunzi, humans by nature are like warped pieces of wood that must be steamed, put into a press, and forced to bend into a straight shape.

He holds that even children must be taught to love their parents and be filial, a position contrary to that of Mencius, who thinks this is a natural inclination. Xunzi believed that if Mencius was correct and human nature was such as to move persons toward the good like water flowing downhill, then there would be no necessity for the emergence of morality or li (Xunzi; Watson 1963: 253).

In Chapter 17 of the Xunzi, Xunzi makes the point that Heaven does not care about human behavior, or how the course of things affects humans. In this, he takes a view much different than that of Mozi. Heaven cannot be appeased or persuaded to bring humans good fortune. If there is good fortune for humans, it is because persons make it happen through responsible government and well-ordered society. Neither does Heaven make people poor or bring calamities. Heaven has no will and no mind, and thus does not act to bring judgment or reward. The well being of persons and societies is squarely in the hands of humans acting morally. All are contrary to Mozi’s view.

f. Buddhist Moralities in the Chinese Context

i. The Way of Precepts

In Chinese Buddhism, the moral life is understood in a way similar to the epistemological one. There are multiple levels. On the lowest level, that of the lay followers, Buddhist morality looks in many ways like a conventional moral system. Various Buddhist schools share the basic code of ethics called the Five Precepts for the guidance of life when a seeker is at this lowest level. These entail abstinence from (1) killing, (2) stealing, (3) sexual misconduct, (4) lying, and (5) intoxication. Some Buddhist schools add three or five precepts to these. The so-called Ten Precepts form the conduct guides for monastic orders. The best-known companion concept to Buddhist morality at the level of precepts is the concept of karma. Karma may be regarded in its most basic sense as the product of one’s past actions. These products may be behavioral consequences, mental conditions or physical states that result from one’s acts.

Individuals living by moral precepts may stand out among others as good and ethical. They may receive awards and recognitions. We may seek them out in our relationships. In its highest forms, this is the Buddhism of compassion for the world, which seeks to remove evil and suffering by living a pure life and contributing to the welfare of others.

However, while such persons are still thinking of life and existence under moral precepts, they remain “in training” and in bondage to volition, names and forms of discrimination that persons use, and desire and suffering; even the desire to be good may cause suffering. They are also still subject to mental anguish and physical attunement.

A higher level of morality than that of following precepts is possible, even as a result of following those precepts. However, a crucial difference occurs when the training eventuates in enlightenment. In nirvana’s extinguishment of desire and vanishing of suffering, all moral precepts may be dispensed with as well. One who has climbed to the heights no longer needs the ladder. Since one is emptied of the attachments and desires moral precepts are meant to control and erase, there is no longer any need for them, nor any function for them once the job is done and desire is extinguished. Such an enlightened one transcends ethics and precepts, and is set free from morality.

ii. The Hua-yan (Flower Garland) Bodhisattva

Hua-yan (Flower Garland) Buddhism valorizes the form of existence known as Bodhisattva. To be a Bodhisattva is to dwell in the margins between experienced enlightenment and surrounding moral and karmic views. The Bodhisattva has already abandoned desires and the discriminations of the mundane world that are the cause of suffering. Accordingly, such the Bodhisattva dwells in this world with a mind that transcends that which causes suffering and has no attachment to the self. Those still caught in this world are attached to the self and to the discriminations of existence, and they suffer because of the desires such attachment creates. When a Bodhisattva lives among such people, the difference is obvious and the other sentient beings see that the Bodhisattva does not suffer. Thereby, the Bodhisattva becomes a savior.

iii. The Way to Morality in Chan Buddhism

Better known in the West by its Japanese equivalent, Zen, chan comes from the Sanskrit term dhyana, which means “meditation.” Although meditation is not the only practice employed in Chan Buddhism, its central role in ethics is important. In Chan Buddhism, the task is not to use reason or a calculus of consequences of actions in order to arrive at knowledge of one’s duties, but rather a person readies himself to act morally through meditation. This state is empty of content such as rules and duties. Indeed, one who practices this as a component of ethics does not say that he “knows” what to do or what is right. Rather, one has set aside the need to speak of the ethical life as connected to moral knowledge. In this state, persons have no need to draw their bearings from culture, community, or any sacred book. For such persons, meditation is the key. It is a sort of alternate consciousness that will enable one to act spontaneously, without calculation or feelings of resistance from the will. Similarities between Chan Buddhism and the concept of wuwei in Lao-Zhuang provide the backdrop for many historical instances of contact and exchange between the traditions.

g. Zhu Xi: Fashioning the Human Being

Whereas Western philosophers often engage in a discussion of the ultimate meaning or goal of human life, frequently associating it with happiness, Zhu Xi identifies the fundamental purpose of human life and its moral objective as equilibrium and harmony (zhonghe). For Zhu Xi, when humans realize equilibrium and harmony to the highest degree, heaven and earth will attain their proper order and all things will flourish. Accordingly, the purpose of morality is self-mastery by yielding to the Principle(s) (li) underlying reality. It is never merely self-realization. Rather, the person of ren (humaneness) “forms one body” with all things. Those who make a cleavage between objects and distinguish between the self and others are petty persons; that is, xiao ren.

Zhu’s ontology is closely connected with his approach to morality. Rather than taking the view that human nature is good or evil, his position is that owing to the way the five phasal elements come together to shape humans, one will be enabled to express the principles and patterns of Heaven. That is, one will be a sage or an evil person, mentally deranged, or a genius (Conversations 4.13, 15). Zhu thinks that he has thereby resolved the philosophical debate between Mencius and Xunzi.

Harmony for Zhu Xi is not so much “knowing yourself,” as Socrates would have it, nor is it identical with Aristotle’s eudaimonia (human flourishing). However, Zhu may well have taken the position that he (harmony) is necessary to both the Socratic and Aristotelian project. Yet, we may wonder whether harmony is a sufficiently robust and satisfying moral ultimate for human life. The question, then, is whether this calls us to the highest levels of achievement as humans.

h. Wang Yangming: Moral Willing as Knowing

While Wang Yangming was critical of Zhu Xi’s thought, he was influenced by the Neo-Confucian thinkers who went before him. Wang adopted their vision that the great man can regard Heaven, earth, and the myriad things as one body, holding that one does so not because he rationally decides to, but because it is natural to his heart-mind (xin)

In contrast to Zhu’s stance of “forming one body” with all things, Wang holds that the “great person” moves by pure intelligence (liangzhi). There is a direct awareness of being one with those in need and acting on that awareness. For Wang, “awareness” is not simply “feeling” or “reason,” which form the usual extremes in Western thought. Rather, feeling and reason are combined as in the Chinese notion of “heart-mind” (xin). This meaning of awareness gives the agent a unifying perspective for experiencing and dealing with all persons, things, and events.

Wang thinks that the direct awareness of Heavenly Principle(s) (tianli) as a moral guide is discovered not by following a moral exemplar, obeying a divine command, or by utilitarian quantification of what action will yield the greatest happiness for the greatest number. Neither does it come into view at the end of a rational process of solving a dilemma one might face. Rather, awareness of tianli is discovered by introspection.

For Wang, the experience of moral enlightenment in liangzhi transforms desire and affections so that individuals freely act. By acting freely, the Way is known. This is the crucial point. Wang is not saying that people who know what is the right thing to do must use their will to redirect their desires and passions in acting upon this knowledge. Rather, he is saying that the transformation of the will is knowledge of the good (Instructions for Practical Living sec. 5).

Yet, we may ask how to distinguish choice through liangzhi from simply “doing what one wants to do” or what “one’s conscience tells one to do”. Wang anticipates this criticism by insisting that, while liangzhi is inherent in all persons, it is the distinguishing characteristic of the mind of the sage. As one prepared by study and deep reflection, the sage’s grasp and awareness of liangzhi is beyond the ordinary. So, one who does not practice like a sage cannot hope to experience his or her own internal powers of liangzhi.

i. Mou Zongsan (1909-1995): Moral Metaphysics

Mou Zongsan coined the term “moral metaphysics” and understood this activity to be primarily occupied with the most basic existential inquires of humans, such as “What should I do?” and “What makes my life meaningful?” Mou argued that in doing moral metaphysics one must notice a two-directional movement between the human and Heaven. He thus used the concept to focus on the transcendent sources of morality. Mou borrowed the philosophical framework of German philosopher Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), but offered his reading of the Neo-Confucians as a corrective to points he believed Kant had gotten wrong.

He understood Kant’s view to be that morality was a priori. In the Groundwork on the Metaphysics of Morals (1785) and The Critique of Practical Reason (1788) Kant developed a method for identifying the pure moral duties of humans by subjecting any candidate’s duty to what he called the Categorical Imperative: “act always on the maxim which you can will to be universal law.”

For Mou, the Neo-Confucian understanding of equilibrium (zhong 中) in the heart-mind (xin) of every person, where the Principle(s) of Heaven were known immediately, was to be preferred to Kant’s Categorical Imperative.

Mou realized that his position required one to commit to a metaphysics (ontology) in a way that Kant’s did not. This is one of the reasons he inverted Kant’s way of speaking about “the metaphysics of morals,” by which Kant meant to identify the presuppositions for morality as we have them.

According to Mou, the Principle(s) of morality could be apprehended by a direct, immediate awareness of the heart-mind, not by the use of Practical Reason as Kant argued. Moreover, he held that creative free action is a manifest reality in the lives of the sages, not merely a postulate of pure practical (moral) reason as Kant held (Mou 1968: 10-13; 43-5). Mou argued that the sages had also connected the finite (what Kant called the phenomenal world) with the infinite (the Principle(s) or what Kant called the noumenal world).

In Kant, the highest good is when happiness occurs in exact proportion to virtue. But Kant said the confluence of optimal virtue and happiness does not and cannot occur in this world. So, morality requires that we postulate both an immortal soul and a God who is able to bring virtue and happiness together. Mou objected to this analysis in Kant, because he thought that personalizing the process that brings virtue and happiness together only pushed the problem to another level. Mou did not see how postulating God provides assurance that virtue and happiness would coincide. How would we know that God would wish to bring virtue and happiness together? Mou preferred another resolution; he held that the concrete example of the sages proved that Heavenly Principle(s) can be manifested in human practice and need not require postulation of an afterlife. Additionally, he held that the sages had lived lives of happiness and virtue, eliminating the grounds used by Kant to postulate both immortality and God.

4. Political Philosophy: Fundamental Questions on Society and Government

Political philosophy is concerned with questions such as these: Prior to government and law, was humanity’s natural state one of freedom and equality, independence or sociality? Were humans inevitably in conflict or did they live in innocent bliss? Does government arise from a contract between persons, the recognized superiority of some persons to lead, or the decree of a higher power? Do we arrive at human laws by participatory exchange of views, do they derive from the nature of reality, are they codifications of the lives of exemplary persons, or are they decrees of rulers or a divine being? What is the best form of government? What is the purpose of government? Are there checks and balances on governments and rulers? Is revolt against the ruler or government ever justified? What is the proper balance between governmental authority and individual liberty of expression and thought? What is the role and responsibility of government to implement justice? In distributing goods, for example, are there rules of entitlement, fairness, equality of opportunity?

a. Confucius on Rulership and the Nature and Function of Politics

Rulership and governance is a principal theme of the Analects (Books 2, 11, 12). Indeed, several of Confucius’s disciples were apprenticed to him to learn the skills and wisdom necessary to become ministers and rulers. The most fundamental characterization of Confucius’s view of rulership is that he believed in a meritocracy. Rulers should ascend to power based on their merit, not their heredity or as a result of having won an election. Confucius’s meritocratic theory is not necessarily anti-democratic, but neither does it elevate democratic process above the higher value of the ruler’s character. Further, there is much in the Analects that suggests Confucius believed that common persons of his day were not prepared or able to participate in government.

Rulers should be exemplary persons, and those who possess virtue (de) will have no difficulty with their people or their kingdom. The classical Confucian ideal is expressed as “nei sheng wai wang” (“internally a sage, externally a ruler”). In an exchange with Ji Kangzi, Confucius says that the ruler who is an exemplary person can affect the entire kingdom with appropriateness (yi) and moral excellence (de), like the wind that blows over the grass (12.19).

Confucius recognizes the need for civil law to extend beyond the rites of propriety and morality (li). However, he also believes that leading the people by political measures and keeping them in place by civil law cannot ensure that the people will develop a sense of shame. Therefore, the measures and law are not sufficient to guarantee order. In contrast to such a style of rulership, a lord who can lead the people by means of his own virtuous power (de) will create a citizenry of honor and virtue. Most importantly, the lord’s governance will create trust (xin) between him and the people.

One of the classical “five relationships” of Confucianism is the relationship between rulers and the people being analogous to a family dynamic. The exemplary ruler will treat the people as though they are his children. Such filial conduct coming from the ruler will create among the people a sense of trust in the king and ministers. Confucius employs the concept of trust instead of “contract” or “agreement” concepts that have been the bedrock of Western political models since the 18^th century.

Confucius did not believe that any given ruler had a “divine right” to be king. Rather, he held that the ruler that shows evidence of proper conduct––namely, self-cultivation and implementing corrections to real or potential harms to the people––would earn him the right to rule. As a result the ruler would win the peoples’ respect and loyalty. “If proper in their own conduct, what difficulty would they have in governing? But if not able to be proper in their own conduct, how can they demand such conduct from others?” (Analects 13.13)

In contrast with minimal intrusion and maximal liberty that characterize Western civil libertarian models, a properly governed state is a value-laden one that produces an environment in which each person may achieve self-cultivation. When listing the tasks of government in order of importance, Confucius names cultivating the trust of the people first, then provision of food, and lastly security and defense (12.7). Western civil libertarian systems, for all their strengths and values, are not necessarily committed to the goal of creating an environment for self-cultivation. They may maximize liberty, but increased freedom does not equate to self-cultivation. For Confucius, politics is rectification or correction (zheng zhe, zheng ye) (12.17). The purpose of politics is to correct deficiencies or mistakes that impede the self-cultivation of each person. While taking a vote may resolve a policy question in participatory governments, it does not actually guarantee that the result is right and correct, which is one reason why Confucius looks to the exemplary leader rather than other models such as democracy or parliamentary debate.

While Confucius holds that filial respect should guide citizens’ conduct toward their rulers, he does not advocate blind obedience. Both Confucius and Mencius state that showing remonstrance with rulers is the responsibility of all who want a truly humane society.

b. Political Philosophy in the Mozi

The basic project of the Mohists was to establish a morally founded social order based on the will of Heaven. To do this, Mozi advocates a system of political hierarchy with the ruler at the top. Even so, the will of Heaven remains as the polity’s governing principle rather than the ruler’s will, his own personal gain or a democratic decision. According to Mozi, the function of this principle is to care for the people universally (jian ai) and benefit the people according to their needs.

The reason Mozi insists that government be structured in a hierarchy under Heaven’s instruction is his view of what Western philosophy has called “the state of nature;” a time before the existence of government. Mozi holds that in that state, there existed a multiplicity of moralities and values. Such pluralism and relativism did not lead to a social contract; rather, it turned people against each other. Only a true and absolute moral system given by Heaven can overcome such relativism and its resulting conflict.

Mozi states that the one who is the most worthy and understands the Way of Heaven (tiandao) is selected by Heaven and established as the Son of Heaven (Mozi 11.2). The worthy ruler is someone who has Heaven’s intention, just like wheelwrights have compasses and carpenters have squares. Wheelwrights and carpenters use their compasses and squares to evaluate circles and squares in the world, claiming that what conforms is right, what does not conform is wrong. The ruler governs by the standards of Heaven. The result is that unity of the people under a set of laws or principles does not come by mutual agreement but by the silencing of divergent points of view under a ruler who enacts the will of Heaven.

What is interesting about Mozi’s theory is that the common people should not only exhibit strict obedience to the rulers, but they should emulate them in their behavior. This is called “exalting worthiness,” and it represents Mozi’s view on the strength and purpose of a political community (Mozi 8.7). He argues for a strong version of political authoritarianism; a centralized state with a hierarchical, tightly organized bureaucracy. This structure, properly conceived of, will lead to the benefit of the people.

c. Mencius’s Political Philosophy

Mencius’s political philosophy is often neglected in a study of Chinese thought. Unlike Mozi, who explored the origin of government and offered a kind of “state of nature” argument for its emergence, Mencius does not speculate about the circumstances that gave rise to government. Instead, he is interested in providing a robust constructivist philosophical ideology called “benevolent government” (renzheng).

Mencius was well-placed to write such a theory. He was a shi, or scholar who traveled from state to state, seeking to be a ruler’s political advisor or military strategist. These traveling advisors often had a significant influence on the ruler, and some of them even became powerful high-ranking officials.

For Mencius, a ruler who practices benevolent governance should do at least the following things: reduce punishment and taxation (1A5), rejoice with his people (1B1), make sure that the masses are neither cold nor hungry (1A7), take no pleasure in executions or war (1A6), let no one starve to death (1A4), and take care of four types of people who are the most needy; widows, widowers, old people without children, and young children without fathers (1B5). In giving advice to King Xuan, Mencius makes clear that he is following Confucius in holding that the state should be ruled by the virtuous, not by those who are elected by the people or inherit rulership by family lineage.

Mencius thinks it is the obligation of government to ensure that the basic needs of the people are met. Today this would be called the provision of social goods or secondary goods, in contrast to the primary goods of liberty and freedom. He is not intent on teaching that the role of government is to maximize civil liberty. He provides specific advice about how the state should help secure the livelihood of the people, including recommendations about everything from tax rates, to farm management, to the pay scale for government employees (3A3). Mencius also agrees with Confucius that self-cultivation is crucial both for the individual and for society. So he advocates an educational system in the ideal state that would instruct people how to be responsible in their relationships as parent, child, ruler, minister, spouse, and friend (3A4).

According to the Mengzi text, Mencius touches upon the removal of the ruler on several occasions. He says that ministers, but not the common people, should not hesitate to depose a ruler who repeatedly refuses to listen to admonitions against serious mistakes (5B9). Speaking of historical instances in which rulers were removed, Mencius says that a sovereign who mutilates benevolence (ren) or cripples rightness (yi) is an outcast, even if he is an emperor (1B8). If the king is not humane, and if he abuses the people instead of taking care of their welfare, he can be legitimately deposed.

d. Lao-Zhuang and Yellow Emperor Traditions on Rulership and Government

The logia of the Daodejing make it clear that reality left alone moves as it should, and that it is human tampering with relationships and attempts to guide and orchestrate things that make a mess of life. Morality and law are evidences of such tampering. “Only when the great Way (Dao) is abandoned, do morals and laws of benevolence and righteousness arise” (DDJ 18). “The more taboos and prohibitions there are in the world, the poorer the people… The more laws and edicts, the more there will be thieves and robbers.” (DDJ 5). Ideally, the follower of the dao will not engage in rulership or political machination at all because there will be no need to do so. In fact, human efforts to manage life through law, morality, and governmental policy only make matters worse (DDJ 29). In this connection, the text is famous for its aphorism that ruling a state is like cooking a small fish (DDJ 60), the point of which is that the least amount of tampering is best, as though the ruler should allow the Dao to take its course without manipulation by government.

There is no question that the Lao-Zhuang philosophical tradition wanted to reduce governmental control. “The more dull and passive the government, the more honest and agreeable the people. The more active and [interventionist] the government, the more deformed and deficient the people’s lives will be” (DDJ 60). Rulers should be well within the background and not seek a name for themselves. “The greatest of rulers is but a shadowy presence; next is the ruler who is loved and praised; next is the one who is feared; next is the one who is reviled” (DDJ 17).

Chapters 1-7 of the Zhuangzi tend to continue these same emphases from the Daodejing, calling governing by law and structure “a bogus virtue,” as futile as drilling into a river (ZZ Ch. 7). These chapters make it clear that Daoist masters did not seek, and even actively avoided, positions as officials or rulers. Chapter 28 contains a long series of text logia all dealing with rulership, designed to show that when they were approached with the offer of political employment, famous Daoist masters refused it, fled into far regions, or even attempted suicide.

However, in the Zhuangzi’s Yellow Emperor-Laozi Daoist (Huang-lao) lineage materials (ZZ Ch. 11-16; 18-19) a different view of rulership is expressed. These sections do not recommend turning away from political involvement. Instead, they say that in the early period of his rule the Yellow Emperor used the Confucian virtues of benevolence (ren) and righteousness (yi) to meddle with the minds of men. What followed was a history of consternation and confusion, all the way down to the Confucians and Mohists who are mentioned by name. However, the Yellow Emperor then underwent a transformation and learned the “Perfect Dao” on the Mountain of Emptiness and Identity (Kongtong). When he returned to rule and followed wuwei, his kingdom became peaceful, and he became an immortal transcendent (xian) (ZZ Ch. 11). The views of the Yellow Emperor-Laozi tradition are more developed in the important work Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi), edited under Liu An and presented in 139 B.C.E. to the Han imperial court.

e. Legalism and Hanfei (280?-230? B.C.E.)

The term “Legalism” or the “Legalist School” (fa jia) first appeared in Sima Qian’s Records of the Historian circa 90 B.C.E. Traditionally, Guan Zhong (d. 645 B.C.E.?) is called “the father of Legalism”. However, calling “Legalism” a school is somewhat misleading because there was no “school” of this thought per se; it was more of a philosophy of law and its practice. A number of philosophers associated with this approach were active in government as ministers, officials, and imperial consultants. For example, Shang Yang (d. 338 B.C.E.) was a chancellor of the Qin state and Shen Buhai (d. 337 B.C.E.) held a similar position in the Han state. Hanfei (280?-230 B.C.E.) was an advisor in the Han state, just prior to its annexation by Qin in creating China’s first empire in 221 B.C.E. It is generally acknowledged that Qinshihuang (birth name, Ying Zheng, 260-210 B.C.E.), the first emperor of China, as well as advisors such as Li Si (280?-208 B.C.E.) followed Legalist writings in unifying the diverse states of China into an empire. Possibly, they followed a version of the text called Hanfeizi.

Hanfei shared a view of human nature somewhat similar to that of Xunzi. He thought the natural aspirations of the people are such that they all move toward security and benefit. Xunzi held that public-spirited people are few while private-minded individuals are numerous. While this is not a well-developed theory of the “state of nature,” it was adequate to pose the problem faced by explaining where the state comes from and what is its necessity for Hanfei. His recommended solution for “private-mindedness” is the establishment of government.

Still, Hanfei does not mean that human nature is evil. He simply means that humans give primacy to their own self-interest. The carriage maker hopes that men will grow rich and eminent so that he can sell carriages. The coffin maker wants persons to continue to pass away, so that he can stay in business, but not because he is evil or wishing others bad fortune.

Hanfei has a deep appreciation for the power of socio-economic forces on the life of humans and any society they create. He is not a complete economic determinist, but he feels that resources and scarcity play a role in the extent to which one will adhere to social order. In taking this position, Hanfei anchors his political theory on the belief that human action is a by-product of the socio-economic environment in which persons live. So, creating a state in which the resources are sufficient, available to all, and fairly distributed is the single best way to encourage moral goodness, peace, and societal harmony.

This means that if a ruler wants and needs his people to work diligently, he must motivate them by an appeal to their self-interests. Moreover, the skillful ruler should set up policies and administer the state so that an individual’s maximization of his own self-interest will also enlarge the public interest and the state.

Unlike Confucian, Mohist, Mencian, and Lao-Zhuang traditions, an ideal for Hanfei state does not depend on having a virtuous ruler. Even a ruler who is morally deficient in his own personal life may, nevertheless, be a good ruler if he sets up the proper policies and administration by means of five tactics: the use of the power of position; the employment of administrative methods; the making of laws; taking hold of the two handles of government (reward and punishment); and the non-action (wuwei) of the ruler.

Hanfei’s separation of politics from morality is an approach that earlier Chinese philosophers would not have accepted. To put it succinctly, while previous classical Chinese political philosophies insisted on rule by the virtuous (for example, a meritocracy) and a close association between morality and politics, Hanfei sees no difficulty in considering both the ruler and politics as amoral.

f. Political Thought in the Han Dynasty (206 B.C.E.-220 C.E.)

i. Dong Zhongshu (179-104 B.C.E.)

When Han Emperor Wu took control of the state, he consulted scholars and officials to gain advice on how to govern. Dong Zhongshu wrote several documents designed to reform government that used Confucian ideology paired with an ontology of the resonance (ganying) between human action and Heaven’s activity; that is, acting morally good will result in Heaven’s blessing in health, position, and longevity. Dong recommended the establishment of a Grand Academy (taixue) to train those who would serve the government in the skills they would need.

His most important works are contained in the Luxuriant Gems of the Spring and Autumn Annals. Dong continued the emphases of Confucius and Mencius calling for rule by the meritorious and for the establishment of a humane (ren) government. A principal difference between Dong and Confucius and Mencius is that he attached more significance to the role of Heaven in validating policy and social structure as a transcendent power. The ruler and his ministers were subject to the authority of Heaven, and their task was to do good and proper acts, setting up the kind of resulting resonance that would be seen in Heaven’s blessings. Violation of the principles of Heaven would bring disturbances in the natural, human, and spiritual worlds.

Dong built his philosophy on a much heavier reliance on the transcendent than can be seen in Confucius, Mencius, or Xunzi. Rulers must follow the principles of Heaven and fulfill its mandate, or else disaster will follow. He even speaks of Heaven as the “great grandfather” (zeng zufu) of humanity. And yet, following Confucius, Dong insisted that in order to carry out the will of Heaven, a ruler must rely on education and the rites rather than punishment and killing.

Applying the explanatory system of the five elemental phases, Dong wrote that rulers should practice, and the state should inculcate, the five virtues: humaneness (ren), rightness (yi), propriety (li), wisdom (zhi) and loyalty (xin). Dong believed strongly that all political activity should reflect the five phases. To be in accordance with these phases, he even called for a new calendar to be issued, colors of banners to be changed, monuments redesigned, and complete revision of other trappings of government.

ii. Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi 139 B.C.E.)

According to his biography in the Book of the Early Han (Hanshu, 44.2145) Liu An, the king of Huainan (in modern Anhui province) and uncle of Han Emperor Wu, gathered a large number of scholars and practitioners of esoteric techniques to Huainan in the period 160-140 B.C.E., and supported them in the creation of written works synthesizing their views. The Masters of Huainan (Huainanzi) was a product of this interchange of ideas.

It is a work focused on educating a ruler on the tasks before him. In the text we find a theory of the fall of humanity from an original harmony in the state of nature to human government and politics with its attendant disorder and violence. Instead of government resulting from agreement between persons for whom there is no law, where the powerful can enforce their will over the weak, the text takes the reverse approach. The primal state is presented as a natural, spontaneous, and peaceful existence. Government is then the source of humanity’s problems, not a solution.

Chapter nine of the Masters of Huainan (HZ) is entitled “The Ruler’s Techniques,” and its focus is on the methods that a ruler should use to create a humane and orderly government. The first, and certainly the most important technique, for a ruler is to act in wuwei. This does not mean the ruler should do absolutely nothing. It means that when he acts, nothing comes from him personally (HZ 9.23); that is, his policies are neither biased by his private preferences (HZ 9.25), nor are they restricted by the limits of his own vision for the state (HZ 9.9-9.11). Instead, his actions implement the movement of the Way (Dao) of Heaven (HZ 9.2).

The best form of government, the text suggests, is one where the ruler devotes himself to wuwei. Ideal rulers of the distant past such as Fuxi, Nuwa, and the Yellow Emperor (Huangdi) are described as being its adherents (HZ 6.7). By following their spontaneous natures and aligning themselves with profound wuwei, the world naturally became harmonious (HZ 8.5).

g. Zhu Xi on Law as the Enforcement of Morals

Zhu Xi shared Confucius’s distrust for the ability of law alone to bring order in society and to cultivate the people. He recognized that government and law were necessary, but considered them insufficient to bring about social order; virtue and ritual were still important. Virtue, law, rites, and punishments should complement each other. Zhu made an important contribution to Chinese political theory by insisting that governing by virtue and ritual was compatible with a system of laws and punishments, and he argued that Confucius’s protest against reliance on law was motivated by the context in which he lived, when some rulers made no use of virtue or the rites (li) at all.

In fact, Zhu Xi supported the use of law to assist in the moral education of the populace. The purpose of law was not merely to protect those in the society from harm or injury. It was also to shape the character of the society and its people. Accordingly, government not only had the right but also the obligation to engineer the morality of society and control what the people could do morally.

Nevertheless, Zhu Xi was aware of the long history of abuse of the power to make law, grant amnesties, and remit punishment practiced by Song dynastic rulers. He argued that laws must be clear and the enforcement of them must be just. He challenged directly the practice of amnesty (dashe) as frequently degenerating into a form of favoritism and injustice. By insisting on the enforcement of law and punishment of offenders, Zhu is often misunderstood as being akin to the worst abusers of law as found in the Legalist tradition. However, he was not advocating severity of punishment as a value in itself, but rather recommending the just administration of law as the active enforcement of morals, using politics as a means of moral cultivation.

h. Yan Fu (1854-1921): China Not Ready for Democracy

After the first Sino-Japanese War of 1894-1895, China entered into the period that one might call Modern Chinese Philosophy where there was an influx of texts and ideas from the Western world. Yan Fu became the most influential translator of Western works in China. In fact, Yan was not only the greatest authority on Western philosophy in China at the beginning of the 20^th century, but also he was the first scholar to systematically introduce Western philosophy by translating a significant number of works: Thomas Henry Huxley’s Evolution and Ethics (1893), published in Chinese in 1898; Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations (1776), published in Chinese in 1902; Herbert Spencer’s The Study of Sociology (1872) and John Stuart Mill’s On Liberty (1859), both translations published in Chinese in 1904; Charles de la Secondat de Montesquieu’s The Spirit of the Laws (1748), John Stuart Mill’s A System of Logic (1843), translated in 1905, and William Stanley Jevon’s The Theory of Political Economy (1878), translated in 1909.

Yan was a true cultural intermediary who, at a critical moment in history, sought to make European works of philosophy and social science accessible to a Chinese readership. He put forward a form of Social Darwinism according to which social organization is also a product of evolution and subject to its same laws and processes.

He declares that both the Western powers and Japan, which had invaded and exploited China, were nevertheless morally and intellectually “superior.” In his view, China had become “inferior” as a result of its inability to excel in the international competition of worldviews, technology, and socio-political structures. He made his thought clear that in order for China to fare well in global competition with other nations it must alter its societal structure.

Yan claimed that the reason why China was weaker and less able to compete compared to the Western nations was its lack of liberty for its people. Yan not only accepted Mill’s view in On Liberty that the strength of a body politic lies in its commitment to the discovery of truth but he also recognized that liberty of expression and inquiry is essential to pursuit and recognition of truth. Accordingly, he extended the point to claim that liberty is essential in order to produce a strong nation. When people lack liberty, they will not be motivated to fight for the state or work hard in order to create a productive society.

Prior to Yan Fu, the concept of liberty that he was drawing from Mill does not mean doing whatever one wants. Society has genuine interests that might be harmed by indiscriminate freedom of action. Moreover, society has a right to transmit a set of values and cultural practices that can limit freedom of the individual. But Yan cautions that China’s highly structured moral beliefs and social rituals can overwhelm liberty if not properly watched.

To this point, there had not been any rigorous analysis of the nature and place of liberty in Chinese political philosophy. While some philosophical defenses of remonstrance with parents or rulers can be found in the history of Chinese philosophy, the function of this concept is much different than what Mill means by one’s individual free expression of lifestyle. Accordingly, when Chinese intellectuals began reading Mill and Yan’s commentaries on the translation, a new way of looking at society and a person’s place within it came into view.

Yan was forced to defend himself against conservative critics in China who felt the radicalism of a civil libertarian society represented danger and the possibility of chaos. His strategy was to claim that although society should not interfere with individual human liberty, neither should the individual do anything to harm society by his free expression. Accordingly, Yan’s translation of Mill’s work was published under the title, On the Borderline between Society’s and Individuals’ Power. In his comments on the book, Yan extended Mill’s “harm principle,” to include a legitimate political power to restrict freedom in the name of the protection of societal and communal integrity and value.

Nevertheless, Yan did not support China’s 1911 revolution to create a Republic and disestablish the Qing dynasty. Rather, he insisted on gradual political reform. He thought that improved education for the Chinese population was needed before the people would be ready to participate in government; the Chinese people at the turn of the 20^th century, Yan believed, were not yet ready for participatory government and responsible use of free expression.

i. Liang Qichao (1873-1929): Emergent Chinese Nationalism

Xiao Yang (17) calls Liang Qichao “the most widely read public intellectual during the transitional period from the late Qing dynasty (1644-1912) to the Republican era (1912-49)”. For Liang Qichao, the central task of philosophy is to perfect the principles and rules necessary for social affairs within a political system. He thought an authentic philosopher was not so much an ontologist or epistemologist as a jingshi; that is, a statesman or scholar who practices statesmanship.

Liang built his early political philosophy from 1896-1903 on the position that the myriad things of existence move continuously toward integration and grouping (qun). He read Thomas Huxley’s Evolution and Ethics, and he interpreted Huxley’s findings to mean that higher evolutionary development always took place when solidarity and group harmony became overriding intentions, whether in kinship lines, groups, tribes, or emergent human societies. This position led him to distinguish between the moral virtues that related to individual personal conduct (side) and civic or public virtues (gongde), which were necessary for the creation of a healthy and ideal society. Liang proposed to develop a modern Chinese political philosophy designed to produce what he called a “new citizenry” (xinmin) for China.

Liang took the Chinese term min (people), which was used to mark the people that made up a population, and replaced it with the concept guomin (citizens) in an intentional effort to tie individual identity and nationalism together. He believed a philosophically viable political body is not merely made up of a population. The people must be brought into being as citizens who express their powers and right to self-government, otherwise the nation itself ceases to exist and becomes something ultimately destructive to human flourishing.

In his essay, “On the Progress China has made in the Last Fifty Years” (1922), Liang held to two principles. The first, which he called “the spirit of nation building,” was “Anyone who is not Chinese has no right to govern Chinese affairs” (Liang 7). The second, known as “the spirit of democracy,” was “Anyone who is Chinese has the right to govern Chinese affairs” (Liang 4031).

j. Mao Zedong (1893-1976): The Sinification of Marxism

Marxist writings were introduced to China as part of the movement called “Western Learning” (Xi xue). The first reference to Western socialism seems to be in an essay by Yan Fu. However, Zhao Bizhen’s translation of Fukui Junzo’s Modern Socialism in 1903 was the first comprehensive introduction of Marxism into China. In 1912, a Chinese translation of Friedrich Engels’s Socialism: Utopian and Scientific was serialized in issues 1-7 of “The New World” (Xin Shijie). The Chinese version of Karl Marx and Friedrich Engels’ Communist Manifesto (Gongchangdang xuanyan) was translated by Chen Wangdao and published in April 1919. In 1931, Chen Qixiu translated Das Kapital, the fundamental text of Marxist economics.

While many Chinese intellectuals wrote on Marxism in the early part of the 20^th century, no thinker is as important to the sinification of Marxism as Mao Zedong. While some would question Mao’s credentials as a philosopher, he did, however, educate himself extensively on Chinese history and philosophy. His concerns were directed into a relatively narrow range of philosophical inquiry: social, political, and economic thought.

Mao thought that Marxism must be made to engage with the specific and particular situation of the Chinese people and culture. He held that Chinese Communists must learn how to apply the theories of Marxism-Leninism to concrete situations in China, enabling an application of Marxist philosophy that is uniquely Chinese in all circumstances.

Several factors are important to note about how and why Marxism assumed its particular form in China in the 1940s-1970s. Perhaps most important of these is that Chinese Marxism drew on the Chinese intellectual tradition in ways that minimized some of the difficulties that are found in Western Marxism. Long before the introduction of Marxist thought, Chinese philosophical history embraced the principles of the socio-economic significance to communal order, a humanistic non-religious worldview, dialectical social and intellectual processes, and authoritarian rule by an enlightened elite. When Marxism was rendered into the Chinese target language, its central concept of “dialectics” was translated as tongbian or “continuity through change,” a concept used historically in Chinese tradition.

Instead of using yin and yang to translate Marxist “dialectics,” Mao’s uses the terms mao (spear) and dun (shield), employing a famous story taken from the Hanfeizi. In the story a dialectical tension emerges when a man offers to sell both an invincible sword and an impenetrable shield. Mao uses this example to highlight the inevitability of the dynamic interaction of divergent views that contradict each other. For Mao, only actual political practice and societal change, not intellectual cognition or language, can fully overcome the tongbian (dialectics) of Chinese social and economic realities. Dialectics is not an academic exercise, but a revolutionary one.

In what became known as “Mao Zedong Thought,” Mao called for a “New Democracy” where power would be taken from the organizations and persons that had perpetuated China as a semi-colonial and semi-feudal society and given to a new revolutionary leadership of the people who would transform China into a new socialist state. He spoke of this change as a dictatorship of the revolutionary leadership and a democratic centralism. Rather than the product of universal suffrage, by “democratic” he meant “oriented toward the people” (Mao, June 30, 1949 and February 27, 1957).

The “New Democracy” would require a “New Economy” in which the new government would own the banks and industrial and commercial enterprises in order to prevent them from dominating the livelihood of the people (Mao February 27, 1957). Eventually, these political ideas found expression in the “iron rice bowl” (tie fanwan) and state-owned enterprises, as a vision of the ways government should pursue distributive justice.

k. Forms of Contemporary Confucian Political Theory

i. Tu Weiming

One thinker who is contributing to a renewal and revision of political theory by constructing a New Confucian social theory is Tu Weiming. In his Reinventing Confucianism: the New Confucian Movement, Umberto Bresciani names Tu as the leader of the “third generation” of New Confucians. Tu is Professor of Philosophy and founding Dean of the Institute for Advanced Humanistic Studies at Peking University.

Tu considers Confucianism to be an all-embracing humanism that merges the secular and sacred. He also believes that the Confucian moral ideal of the exemplary person can be realized more fully in a liberal democratic society than in either the traditional imperial monarchies or modern authoritarian regimes. Moreover, he argues that Confucianism adapted for the contemporary period is an antidote to the deficiencies of Western philosophy that gives insufficient importance to the idea of community and privileges the political ideals which tend to degenerate into injustice and disorder.

Tu closely associates ethics and politics, and argues that the work of political rectification envisioned by Confucius is one which monitors and constantly adjusts social processes of communal life in order to bring about a “fiduciary community” where each person is not merely permitted, but encouraged, to pursue moral self-cultivation.

Tu suggest that in the Confucian community divergent interests and plural desires are dealt with differently than in social contract and civil libertarian adversarial systems where the tyranny of the majority may be expressed in the ballot. In the fiduciary community, no decision by ruling authority can be regarded as appropriate if it destroys the ethos of trustworthiness among the people or between the people and the government. Such a delimitation of power creates in the community what Tu calls a “convergence of orientations”. The resulting benefit is a fiduciary community where citizens “exhort one another to do good” (bai xing quan) in a learning culture.

While he recognizes the immense value of Western enlightenment rationality, Tu insists that its tools and values must be supplemented by three requirements that can move humanity toward a global ethic: 1) converting from an anthropocentric to an anthropocosmic vision that appreciates the vibrancy of spirituality and removes man from being the measure of all things; 2) revising instrumental rational empiricism to include sympathy and empathy necessary for a full phenomenology of experience; and 3) instantiating the universalizable values of liberty, rationality, law, human rights, and the dignity of the individual.

ii. Jiang Qing

Jiang Qing is a contemporary Chinese Confucian who is best known for his criticism of New Confucianism as expressed by Tu Weiming and others. According to him, New Confucianism deviated from original Confucian principles and is overly influenced by Western liberal democracy. He also feels there is a drift in the Chinese Communist Party that seems unfocused and without direction. He proposes an alternative path for China called “Constitutional Confucianism” or “Political Confucianism.” Jiang believes that China’s ongoing political and social problems are to be solved by the revival of and commitment to what he considers to be authentic Confucianism.

To implement his changes, Jiang argues that Confucian materials should replace the Marxist curriculum taught in China’s universities and government party schools. He has been an advocate for new Confucian academies throughout the country, especially his own retreat called Yangming Spiritual House. He has been a central player in the “Reading of the Classics Movement” (dujing yundong), having edited a 12-volume school textbook titled The Fundamental Texts of Chinese Culture Classics for Reading (2004).

In A Confucian Constitutional Order, Jiang advocates what he calls “Humane Authority” as the guiding value of political process. His new model is expressed through a trilateral parliamentary framework made up of a House of Exemplary Persons that represents the sacred, a House of the Nation that represents historical and cultural legitimacy, and a House of the People that represents popular sentiment.

iii. Kang Xiaoguang

Kang Xiaoguang has taken up the challenge to offer a political philosophy for China’s post-Mao years in several works. An summary of his views in English is by David Ownby (2009). Kang calls for the Chinese Community Party to be Confucianized. He thinks Marxism should be replaced with a reconstituted and adapted philosophical system of Confucius and Mencius. He holds that while the educational system will keep the party schools, their syllabi should be changed, listing the Four Books and Five Classics as required texts. Kang desires a return to the examination system for all promotions in the Chinese bureaucracy and he wants Confucian philosophical teachings to be added to each examination. Moreover, he also maintains that the Chinese society as a whole should be Confucianized. Here the key is to introduce Confucianism into the national education system, adding courses in Chinese culture that Kang claims will impart a value system, a faith, and soul for the culture. In the long term, he thinks that the moral bearings of China can be rebalanced only if Confucianism becomes the state’s civil value system.

iv. Fan Ruiping

Fan Ruiping’s project is set out most clearly in his Reconstructionist Confucianism: Rethinking Morality after the West (2010). In this work, he calls for reclaiming and articulating resources from the Confucian tradition to address contemporary moral and public policy challenges. He sets his effort against both Western civil libertarian democracies and the New Confucianism of Tu Weiming and others. He holds that while Western social philosophy is founded on abstract and general principles, Confucianism is defined by specific rules that identify particular practices leading to a virtuous mode of life developed in the forge of a properly harmonious Confucian family. Fan argues that in such families persons learn how to treat others as unequals and gain mastery of the push and pull of graded love, creating a virtuous familism that is transferable to the society at large. Instead of Western language about rights, Fan holds that the goal in political policy is to treat persons as relatives and the nation and global community as a household drawing on the archetype of a traditional Chinese family that brought many persons into its circle of influence. Rather than norms such as “justice as fairness” (John Rawls), Fan characterizes the Confucian model as “justice as harmony.”

An important source in English for current debates about Confucian reconceptualization of Chinese politics in theory and practice is Fan’s collection of essays entitled The Renaissance of Confucianism in Contemporary China.

5. Epilogue

The history of Chinese philosophy may be approached in many ways. In this article, an overview of many important thinkers has been provided, and their contributions to world philosophy on the topics of ontology, epistemology, moral theory, and political philosophy were discussed. Another viable approach to the history of the tradition would be to demarcate the moves made in Chinese philosophical thought within the flow of Chinese history itself, giving attention also to the interactions between Chinese thinkers and internal dialogues of significance. Both of these approaches can contribute to an appreciation of the significance and value of philosophy and the important place Chinese philosophers play within it.

6. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger. The Art of Rulership: A Study of Ancient Chinese Political Thought. Albany: SUNY Press, 1994.
Angle, Stephen. Contemporary Confucian Political Philosophy: Toward Progressive Confucianism. Malen, MA: Polity Press, 2012.
Bell, Daniel, and Fan Ruiping, eds. A Confucian Constitutional Order: How China’s Ancient Past Can Shape Its Political Future. Princeton: Princeton UP, 2012.
Bernal, Martin. Chinese Socialism to 1907. Ithaca, NY: Cornell UP, 1976.
Bersciani, Umberto. Reinventing Confucianism: The New Confucian Movement. Taipei: Taipei Ricci Institute for Chinese Studies, 2001.
Bishop, Donald, ed. Chinese Thought: An Introduction. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1985.
Blakeley, Donald. “The Lure of the Transcendent in Zhu Xi.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 21.3 (2004): 223-40.
Briere, O. Fifty Years of Chinese Philosophy: 1848-1948. Trans. Lawrence Thompson. New York: Praeger, 1965.
Bruce, Percy. Chu Hsi and His Masters: An Introduction to Chu Hsi and the Sung School of Chinese Philosophy. London: Probsthain & Co., 1923.
Carr, Karen, and Philip J. Ivanhoe. The Sense of Antirationalism: The Religious Thought of Zhuangzi and Kierkegaard. New York: Seven Bridges, 2000.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. A Sourcebook in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1963.
Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. Instructions for Practical Living and Other Neo-Confucian Writings by Wang Yang-Ming. New York: Columbia UP, 1963.
Chang, Carsun. The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought. 2 vols. New York: Bookman Associates, 1957-1962.
Chin, Ann-ping, and Mansfield Freeman. Tai Cheng on Mencius: Explorations in Words and Meaning. New Haven: Yale UP, 1990.
Ching, Julia. To Acquire Wisdom: The Way of Wang Yang-ming. New York: Columbia UP, 1976.
Chou, Chih-P’ing, ed. Collection of Hu Shih’s English Writings. 3 vols. Heidelberg: Foreign Language Teaching and Research Publishing Co., 1995.
Chung-ying, Cheng, and Nicholas Bunnin eds. Contemporary Chinese Philosophy. Malden, MA: Blackwell, 2002.
Cua, Antonio. The Unity of Knowledge and Action: A Study in Wang Yang-ming’s Moral Psychology. Honolulu: U Hawaii Press, 1982.
Cua, Antonio. ed. Encyclopedia of Chinese Philosophy. New York: Routledge, 2003.
De Bary, Theodore, Irene Bloom, and Joseph Adler eds. Sources of the Chinese Tradition: From Earliest Times to 1600 2nd ed. Vol. 1. New York: Columbia UP, 2000.
De Bary, Theodore. The Unfolding of Neo-Confucianism. New York: Columbia UP, 1975.
Fan, Ruiping. Reconstructionist Confucianism: Rethinking Morality after the West. Heidelberg: Springer, 2010.
Fan, Ruiping. ed. The Renaissance of Confucianism in Contemporary China. Heidelberg: Springer, 2011.
Feng, Youlan. A Short History of Chinese Philosophy. Trans. Derk Bodde. New York: Free Press, 1948.
Feng, Youlan. A History of Chinese Philosophy, 2 vols. Trans. Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1952-1953.
Forke, Alfred, trans. Philosophical Essays of Wang Ch’ung. London: Luza, 1907. Complete text available at Hathi Trust Digital Library.
Fraser, Chris. “Knowledge and Error in Early Chinese Thought,” Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy 10.2 (2011): 127–48.
Fraser, Chris. “The Mohist Conception of Reality.” Chinese Metaphysics and its Problems. Eds. Chenyang Li and Franklin Perkins. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 2014.
Gardner, Daniel. Learning to be a Sage: Selections from the Conversations of Master Chu, Arranged Topically. Berkeley: U California Press, 1990.
Graham, A.C. Studies in Chinese Philosophy and Philosophical Literature. Singapore: Institute of East Asian Philosophies, 1986.
Graham, A.C. Yin-Yang and the Nature of Correlative Thinking. IEAP Occasional Paper and Monograph Series, No. 6. Singapore: Institute of East Asian Philosophies, 1986.
Graham, A.C. Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China. LaSalle, IL: Open Court, 1989.
Hsiao, Kung-chuan. A History of Chinese Political Thought, vol. 1. Trans. F.W. Mote. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1979.
Hsu, Sung-Peng. “Hu Shih.” Chinese Thought: An Introduction. Ed. Donald Bishop. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass Publishers, 1995: 364-91.
Hu Shi. The Development of the Logical Method in Ancient China. Shanghai: The Oriental Book Co., 1928.
Hu Shi. “My Credo and Its Evolution.” Living Philosophies: A Series of Intimate Credos. New York: Simon and Schuster, 1931: 235-63.
Hu, Xinhe. “Hu Shi’s Enlightenment Philosophy.” Contemporary Chinese Philosophy. Eds. Chung-ying Cheng and Nicholas Bunnin. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2002: 82-102.
Hutton, Eric, trans. and ed. Xunzi: The Complete Text. Princeton: Princeton UP, 2014.
Ivanhoe, Philip J., and Bryan W. Van Norden, eds. Readings in Classical Chinese Philosophy 2nd ed. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2006.
Jiang, Qing. A Confucian Constitutional Order: How China’s Ancient Past Can Shape Its Political Future. Princeton: Princeton UP, 2013.
Jiang, Xinyan. “Enlightenment Movement.” History of Chinese Philosophy. Ed. Bo Mou. New York: Routledge, 2009: 473-511.
Johnston, Ian, trans. The Mozi: A Complete Translation. New York: Columbia UP, 2010.
Knight, Nick. Rethinking Mao: Explorations in Mao Zedong’s Thought. Lanham, MD: Lexington Books, 2007.
Lai, Karyn. An Introduction to Chinese Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 2008.
Lau, D.C., trans. Mencius. New York: Penguin Books, 2003. A revision of Lau’s landmark 1970 edition.
Liang, Qichao. Liang Qichao Quanji (The Collected Works of Liang Qichao). 10 vols. Beijing: Beijing Publishing House, 1999.
Liao, W.K., trans. Complete Works of Hanfeizi. London: Arthur Probsthain, 1939.
Littlejohn, Ronnie. An Introduction to Chinese Philosophy. London: I.B. Tauris, 2015.
Liu, JeeLoo. An Introduction to Chinese Philosophy: From Ancient Philosophy to Chinese Buddhism. Malden, MA: Blackwell, 2006.
Lowe, Scott. Mo Tzu’s Religious Blueprint for a Chinese Utopia: the Will and the Way. Lewiston, NY: The Edwin Mellen Press, 1992.
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Author Information

Ronnie Littlejohn
Email: ronnie.littlejohn@belmont.edu
Belmont University
U. S. A.

Compositionality in Language

Table of Contents

1. Interpretations of Compositionality

a. Syntactic Structure

b. Meaning

c. Dependence

i. Functional Dependence

ii. The Substitution Principle

iii. Problems for Functional Dependence

iv. Dependence as Computability

v. Dependence as Mereology

vi. The Empirical Conception of Dependence

2. Arguments for Compositionality

a. Novelty

b. Systematicity

c. The Inductive Argument

3. The Dialectical Role of Compositionality in Philosophy

a. Real Meanings

b. Semantic Theories Purportedly at Odds with Compositionality

i. Direct Reference Theory

ii. Conceptual Role Semantics

iii. Verificationism

iv. Moral Non-Cognitivism

4. Challenges to Compositionality

a. The Triviality Objection

b. Context-Sensitive Expressions

c. Idioms

d. Noun Modification

5. Conclusion

6. References and Further Reading

a. General

b. Frege’s Principle

c. Dependence

d. Novelty

e. Systematicity

f. Compositionality vs. Theories of Meaning

g. Triviality

h. Context-Sensitive Expressions

i. Idioms

j. Noun Modification

k. Additional Problems

l. Additional References

Author Information

Chinese Philosophy: Overview of Topics

Table of Contents

1. Ontology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Composition of Reality

a. Formation of the Early Chinese Worldview

i. The Classic of Changes (Yijing) and Its Place in Chinese Philosophy

ii. The Chronicles of Zuo (Zuozhuan, c. 389 B.C.E.)

iii. The “Great Plan” in the Classic of History (Shujing)

b. Mozi, (fl. 470-391 B.C.E.)

c. Lao-Zhuang Daoist Ontology (c. 350-139 B.C.E.)

d. Correlative Cosmologies in the Han Period: Yinyang and Wuxing Heuristics

e. Selected Buddhist Ontologies

i. Tiantai Buddhism (Zhiyi, 538-597 C.E.)

ii. Consciousness-only Buddhism (Weishi Zong)

f. The Neo-Confucian Synthesis of Zhu Xi (1130-1200)

g. Wang Yangming (1472-1529)

h. Shifting Paradigms in Chinese Ontology

i. Dai Zhen (1723-1777)

ii. Hu Shi (1891-1962)

2. Epistemology: Fundamental Questions on the Nature and Scope of Knowledge

a. The Mozi, Later Mohists and Debaters (bianshi)

b. Lao-Zhuang Traditions on Knowing and Truth

c. Mencius (Mengzi, c. 372-289 B.C.E.) and Analogical Reasoning

d. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): Dispelling Obsessions

e. Wang Chong (c. 25-100 C.E.): Critical Chinese Philosophy in the Classical Period

f. Tiantai Buddhism’s Threefold Truth Epistemology

g. Wang Yangming on liangzhi: Direct, Clear, Universal Knowledge

h. Hu Shi (1891-1962): Pragmatism and Experimentalism

i. Zhang Dongsun (1886-1973): Pluralistic Cultural Epistemology

3. Moral Theory: Fundamental Questions on Morality

a. Confucius (551-479 B.C.E.): the Exemplary Person Ideal

b. Mohist Moral Philosophy

c. Lao-Zhuang Traditions and wuwei

d. Mencius (c. 372–289 B.C.E.): Morality as Cultivated Human Nature

e. Xunzi (310-220 B.C.E.): On the Carving and Polishing of the Human Being

f. Buddhist Moralities in the Chinese Context

i. The Way of Precepts

ii. The Hua-yan (Flower Garland) Bodhisattva