Distributive Justice
Theories of distributive justice seek to specify what is meant by a just distribution of goods among members of society. All liberal theories (in the sense specified below) may be seen as expressions of laissez-faire with compensations for factors that they consider to be morally arbitrary. More specifically, such theories may be interpreted as specifying that the outcome of individuals acting independently, without the intervention of any central authority, is just, provided that those who fare ill (for reasons that the theories deem to be arbitrary, for example, because they have fewer talents than others) receive compensation from those who fare well.
Liberal theories of justice consider the process, or outcome, of individuals’ free actions to be just except insofar as this depends on factors, in the form of personal characteristics, which are considered to be morally arbitrary. In the present context these factors may be individuals’ preferences, their abilities, and their holdings of land. Such theories may, then, be categorized according to which of these factors each theory deems to be morally arbitrary.
There is a certain tension between the libertarian and egalitarian theories of justice. Special attention below is given to the views of Dworkin, Rawls, Nozick, and Sen.
Table of Contents
- A Taxonomy
- Justice as Fairness
- Equality of Resources
- Entitlements
- Common Ownership
- Conclusions
- References and Further Reading
1. A Taxonomy
a. A Simple World
We begin with a simple hypothetical world in which there are a number of individuals and three commodities: a natural resource, called land; a consumption good, called food; and individuals’ labour. There is a given amount of land, which is held by individuals, but no stock of food: food may be created from land and labour. An individual is characterized by his preferences between food and leisure (leisure being the obverse of labour); by his ability, or productivity in transforming land and labour into food; and by his holding of land.
Liberal theories of justice consider the process, or outcome, of individuals’ free actions to be just except insofar as this depends on factors, in the form of personal characteristics, which are considered to be morally arbitrary. In the present context these factors may be individuals’ preferences, their abilities, and their holdings of land. Such theories may, then, be categorized according to which of these factors each theory deems to be morally arbitrary.
Equality has various interpretations in this simple world: these correspond to the theories discussed below. Liberty has two aspects: self-ownership, that is, rights to one’s body, one’s labour, and the fruits thereof; and resource-ownership, that is, rights to own external resources and the produce of these. Theories that fail to maintain self-ownership may be divided into those that recognize personal responsibility in that the extent of the incursions that they make are independent of how people exercise these (for example, in being industrious or lazy), and those that do not.
In a liberal context there is (as is justified below) no basis for comparing one individual’s wellbeing with another’s, so that theories of justice which require such comparisons cannot be accommodated. Accordingly, the theories of utilitarianism, which defines a distribution to be just if it maximizes the sum of each individual’s wellbeing, and of equality of welfare, which defines a distribution to be just if each individual has the same level of wellbeing, are not considered.
Four theories of justice are discussed: Rawlsian egalitarianism, or justice as fairness; Dworkinian egalitarianism, or equality of resources; Steiner-Vallentyne libertarianism, or common ownership; and Nozickian libertarianism, or entitlements. The following specification of the theories sets out, for each theory: its definition of justice; the personal characteristics that it considers to be arbitrary and therefore makes adjustments for; the nature of the institution under which this may be achieved; the justification of any inequalities which it accepts; and the extent to which it is consistent with liberty.
Justice as fairness defines a distribution to be just if it maximizes the food that the individual with the least food receives (this is the “maximin” outcome in terms of food, which is the sole primary good). It adjusts for preferences, ability, and land holdings. It is achieved by taxes and subsidies on income (that is, on the consumption of food). Inequalities in income, subject to the maximin requirement, are accepted because of the benefit they bring to the individual with the least income; all inequalities in leisure are accepted. Rights to neither self-ownership nor resource-ownership are maintained, and responsibility is not recognized.
Equality of resources defines a distribution to be just if everyone has the same effective resources, that is, if for some given amount of work each person could obtain the same amount of food. It adjusts for ability and land holdings, but not for preferences. It is achieved by taxes and subsidies on income. Inequalities in both food and leisure are accepted because they arise solely from choices made by individuals who have the same options. Rights to neither self-ownership nor resource-ownership are maintained, but responsibility is recognized.
Common ownership theories define a distribution to be just if each person initially has the same amount of land and all transactions between individuals are voluntary. It adjusts for land holdings, but not for preferences or abilities. It is achieved by a reallocation of holdings of land. Inequalities in both food and leisure are accepted because these arise solely from people having different preferences or abilities. Rights to self-ownership are maintained but rights to resource-ownership are not.
An entitlements theory defines a distribution to be just if the distribution of land is historically justified, that is if it arose from the appropriation by individuals of previously unowned land and voluntary transfers between individuals, and all other transactions between individuals are voluntary. It makes no adjustments (other than corrections for any improper acquisitions or transfers) and thus requires no imposed institution to achieve it. All inequalities are accepted. Rights to both self-ownership and resource-ownership are maintained.
As is apparent, the first two theories emphasize outcomes while the second two emphasize institutions. These four theories form a hierarchy, or decreasing progression, in terms of the personal characteristics that they consider to be morally arbitrary, and thus for which adjustments are made. The first theory adjusts for preferences, ability, and land holdings; the second only for ability and land holdings; the third only for land holdings; and the fourth for none of these (other than the corrections noted above). The four theories form a corresponding hierarchy, or increasing progression, in terms of the liberties (self-ownership, with or without personal responsibility, and resource-ownership) that they maintain: the first maintains neither, and does not recognize responsibility; the second maintains neither, but does recognize responsibility; the third maintains self-ownership but not resource-ownership; and the fourth maintains both self-ownership and resource-ownership.
These corresponding hierarchies are illustrated schematically in the table below (from Allingham, 2014, 4).
| Theory |
Arbitrary factors |
Liberties maintained |
| Rawls |
Preferences – Ability – Land |
– |
| Dworkin |
Ability – Land |
Responsibility |
| Steiner-Vallentyne |
Land |
Responsibility – Self-ownership |
| Nozick |
– |
Responsibility – Self-ownership – Resource-ownership |
The remainder of this survey develops these theories of justice. It demonstrates that they also form a third hierarchy in terms of equality (of outcome), with Rawls’s justice as fairness as the most egalitarian, followed by Dworkin’s equality of resources, then common ownership in the Steiner-Vallentyne vein, and finally Nozick’s entitlements theory as the least egalitarian. The order in which these theories are discussed differs from that of the decreasing progression in terms of what they consider to be arbitrary: specifically, the discussion of entitlements precedes that of common ownership. The reason for this is that common ownership theories follow temporally, and draw on, Nozick’s entitlements theory.
b. Liberalism
The theories of justice considered are liberal in that they do not presuppose any particular conception of the good. They subscribe to what Sandel calls deontological liberalism: “society, being composed of a plurality of persons, each with his own aims, interests, and conceptions of the good, is best arranged when it is governed by principles that do not themselves presuppose any particular conception of the good” (1998, 1).
The importance of deontological liberalism is that it precludes any interpersonal comparisons of utility. As Scanlon (who supports interpersonal comparisons) accepts, “interpersonal comparisons present a problem insofar as it is assumed that the judgements of relative well-being on which social policy decisions, or claims of justice, are based should not reflect value judgements” (1991, 17). And Hammond, who also supports interpersonal comparisons, accepts that such comparisons “really do require that an individual’s utility be the ethical utility or worth of that individual to the society” (191, 237). If we are not prepared to take a position on someone’s worth to society then we cannot engage in interpersonal utility comparisons. It is in the light of this that Arrow notes that “it requires a definite value judgement not derivable from individual sensations to make the utilities of different individuals dimensionally compatible and a still further value judgement to aggregate them”, and accordingly concludes that “interpersonal comparison of utilities has no meaning and, in fact, … there is no meaning relevant to welfare comparisons in the measurability of individual utility” (2012, 9-11).
2. Justice as Fairness
Justice as fairness, as developed by Rawls, treats all personal attributes as being morally arbitrary, and thus defines justice as requiring equality, unless any departure from this benefits everyone. This view is summarized in Rawls’s “general conception of justice”, which is that “all social values – liberty and opportunity, income and wealth, and the social bases of self-respect – are to be distributed equally unless an unequal distribution of any, or all, of these values is to everyone’s advantage”: injustice “is simply inequalities that are not to the benefit of all” (1999, 24).
a. Two Principles
Rawls’s interpretation is made more precise in his two principles of justice. He proposes various formulations of these; the final formulation is that of Political Liberalism:
a. Each person has an equal claim to a fully adequate scheme of equal basic rights and liberties, which scheme is compatible with the same scheme for all; and in this scheme the equal political liberties, and only those liberties, are to be guaranteed their fair value.
b. Social and economic inequalities are to satisfy two conditions: first, they are to be attached to positions and offices open to all under conditions of fair equality of opportunity; and second, they are to be to the greatest benefit of the least advantaged members of society (2005, 5-6).
These principles are lexically ordered: the first principle has priority over the second; and in the second principle the first part has priority over the second part. For the specific question of distributive justice, as opposed to the wider question of political justice, it is the final stone in the edifice that is crucial: this is the famous difference principle.
b. A Social Contract
Rawls justifies his two principles of justice by a social contract argument. For Rawls, a just state of affairs is a state on which people would agree in an original state of nature. Rawls seeks “to generalize and carry to a higher order of abstraction the traditional theory of the social contract as represented by Locke, Rousseau, and Kant”, and to do so in a way “that it is no longer open to the more obvious objections often thought fatal to it” (1999, xviii).
Rawls sees the social contract as being neither historical nor hypothetical but a thought-experiment for exploring the implications of an assumption of moral equality as embodied in the original position. To give effect to this Rawls assumes that the parties to the contract are situated behind a veil of ignorance where they do not know anything about themselves or their situations, and accordingly are equal. The intention is that as the parties to the contract have no information about themselves they necessarily act impartially, and thus as justice as fairness requires. As no one knows his circumstances, no one can try to impose principles of justice that favour his particular condition.
c. The Difference Principle
Rawls argues that in the social contract formed behind a veil of ignorance the contractors will adopt his two principles of justice, and in particular the difference principle: that all inequalities “are to be to the greatest benefit of the least advantaged members of society”. This requires the identification of the least advantaged. There are thee aspects to this: what constitutes the members of society; what counts as being advantaged; and how the advantages of one member are to be compared with those of another.
It would seem natural in defining the least advantaged members of society to identify the least advantaged individuals, but Rawls does not do this. Instead, he seeks to identify representatives of the least advantaged group.
The wellbeing of representatives is assessed by their allocation of what Rawls terms primary goods. There are two classes of primary goods. The first class comprises social primary goods, such as liberty (the subject matter of the first part of the second principle of justice) and wealth (the subject matter of the second part of that principle). The second class comprises natural primary goods, such as personal characteristics. Justice as fairness is concerned with the distribution of social primary goods; and of these the difference principle is concerned with those that are the subject matter of the second part of the second principle of justice, such as wealth.
Rawls’s primary goods are “things which it is supposed a rational man wants whatever else he wants”: regardless of what precise things someone might want “it is assumed that there are various things which he would prefer more of rather than less”. More specifically, “primary social goods, to give them in broad categories, are rights, liberties, and opportunities, and income and wealth”. These fall into two classes: the first comprise rights, liberties, and opportunities; and the second, which is the concern of the difference principle, income and wealth. The essential difference between these classes is that “liberties and opportunities are defined by the rules of major institutions and the distribution of income and wealth is regulated by them” (1999, 79).
The construction of an index of primary social goods poses a problem, for income and wealth comprise a number of disparate things and these cannot immediately be aggregated into a composite index. Rawls proposes to construct such an index “by taking up the standpoint of the representative individual from this group and asking which combination of primary social goods it would be rational for him to prefer”, even though “in doing this we admittedly rely upon intuitive estimates” (1999, 80).
d. Choice Behind the Veil
Each contractor considers all feasible distributions of primary goods and chooses one. Because the contractors have been stripped of all distinguishing characteristics they all make the same choice, so there is in effect only one contractor. The distributions that this contractor considers allocate different amounts of primary goods to different positions, not to named persons.
The contractor does not know which position he will occupy, and as he is aware that he may occupy the least advantaged position he chooses the distribution that allocates the highest index of primary goods to that position. That is, he chooses the distribution that maximizes the index of the least advantaged, or minimum, position. Rawls thus considers his “two principles as the maximin solution to the problem of social justice” since “the maximin rule tells us to rank alternatives by their worst possible outcomes: we are to adopt the alternative the worst outcome of which is superior to the worst outcomes of the others” (1999, 132-133).
A major problem with Rawls’s theory of justice is that rational contractors will not, except in a most extreme case, choose the maximin outcome. Despite Rawls claiming that “extreme attitudes to risk are not postulated” (1999, 73) it appears that they are, and thus to choose the maximin distribution is to display the most extreme aversion to risk. In global terms, it is to prefer the distribution of world income in which 7 billion people have just $1 above a widely accepted subsistence income level of $365 a year to the distribution in which all of these except one (who has $365 a year) have the income of the average Luxembourger with $80,000 a year. It is to choose a world of universal abject poverty over one of comfortable affluence for all but one person. As Roemer expresses it, “the choice, by such a [representative] soul, of a Rawlsian tax scheme is hardly justified by rationality, for there seems no good reason to endow the soul with preferences that are, essentially, infinitely risk averse” (1996, 181).
Rawls appreciates that “there is a relation between the two principles and the maximin rule for choice under uncertainty”, and accepts that “clearly the maximin rule is not, in general, a suitable guide for choices under uncertainty”. However, he claims that it is a suitable guide if certain features obtain, and seeks to show that “the original position has these features to a very high degree”. He identifies three such features. The first is that “since the rule takes no account of the likelihoods of the possible circumstances, there must be some reason for sharply discounting estimates of these probabilities”. The second is that “the person choosing has a conception of the good such that he cares very little, if anything, for what he might gain above the minimum stipend that he can, in fact, be sure of by following the maximin rule”. The third is that “the rejected alternatives have outcomes that one can hardly accept” (1999, 132-134). However, none of these three features appears to justify the choice by a rational contractor of the maximin distribution. Accordingly, Roemer concludes that “the Rawlsian system is inconsistent and cannot be coherently reconstructed” (1996, 182).
e. Summary
The strength of Rawls’s theory of justice as fairness lies in its combination of the fundamental notion of equality with the requirement that everyone be better off than they would be under pure equality. However, the theory has a number of problems. Some of these may be avoided by inessential changes, but other problems are unavoidable, particularly that of identifying the least advantaged (with the related problems of defining primary goods and the construction of an index of these), and that of the supposedly rational choice of the maximin principle with, as Harsanyi puts it, its “absurd practical implications” (1977, 47 as reprinted).
3. Equality of Resources
Equality of resources, as developed by Dworkin, treats individuals’ abilities and external resources as arbitrary, but makes no adjustments for their preferences. The essence of this approach is the distinction between ambition-sensitivity, which recognizes differences which are due to differing ambitions, and endowment-sensitivity, which recognizes differences that are due to differing endowments.
a. Initial Resources
Dworkin accepts that inequalities are acceptable if they result from voluntary choices, but not if they result from disadvantages that have not been chosen. However, initial equality of resources is not sufficient for justice. Even if everyone starts from the same position one person may fare better than another because of her good luck, or, alternatively, because of her lesser handicaps or greater talents.
Dworkin motivates his theory of justice with the example of a number of survivors of a shipwreck who are washed up, with no belongings, on an uninhabited island with abundant natural resources. The survivors accept that these resources should be allocated among them in some equitable fashion, and agree that for a division to be equitable it must meet “the envy test”, which requires that no one “would prefer someone else’s bundle of resources to his own bundle” (1981, 285). The envy test, however, is too weak a test: Dworkin gives examples of allocations that meet this test but appear inequitable.
To deal with such cases Dworkin proposes that the survivors appoint an auctioneer who gives each of them an equal number of tokens. The auctioneer divides the resources into a number of lots and proposes a system of prices, one for each lot, denominated in tokens. The survivors bid for the lots, with the requirement that their total proposed expenditure in tokens not exceed their endowment of tokens. If all markets clear, that is, if there is precisely one would-be purchaser for each lot, then the process ends. If all markets do not clear then the auctioneer adjusts the prices, and continues to adjust them until they do.
b. Fortune
Dworkin seeks to make people responsible for the effects of their choices, but not for matters beyond their control. To take account of the latter, he distinguishes between “option luck” and “brute luck”. Option luck is “a matter of how deliberate and calculated gambles turn out”. Brute luck is “a matter of how risks fall out that are not in that sense deliberate gambles” (1981, 293). People should be responsible for the outcomes of option luck, but not of brute luck.
Dworkin’s key argument concerning luck is that “insurance, so far as it is available, provides a link between brute and option luck, because the decision to buy or reject catastrophe insurance is a calculated gamble”. Then because people should be responsible for the outcomes of option luck they should be responsible for the outcomes of all luck, at least if they could have bought insurance. Accordingly, Dworkin amends his envy test by requiring that “any resources gained through a successful gamble should be represented by the opportunity to take the gamble at the odds in force, and comparable adjustments made to the resources of those who have lost through gambles” (1981, 293-295).
c. Handicaps
Insurance cannot remove all risks: if someone is born blind he cannot buy insurance against blindness. Dworkin seeks to take account of this through a hypothetical insurance scheme. He asks how much an average person would be prepared to pay for insurance against being handicapped if in the initial state everyone had the same, and known, chance of being handicapped. He then supposes that “the average person would have purchased insurance at that level” (1981, 298), and proposes to compensate those who do develop handicaps out of a fund that is collected by taxation but designed to match the fund that would have been provided through insurance premiums. The compensation that someone with a handicap is to receive is the contingent compensation that he would have purchased, knowing the risk of being handicapped, had actual insurance been available.
Accordingly, the auction procedure is amended so that the survivors “now establish a hypothetical insurance market which they effectuate through compulsory insurance at a fixed premium for everyone based on speculations about what the average immigrant… would have purchased by way of insurance had the antecedent risk of various handicaps been equal” (1981, 301).
This process establishes equality of effective resources at the outset, but this equality will typically be disturbed by subsequent economic activity. If some survivors choose to work more than others they will produce, and thus have, more than their more leisurely compatriots. Thus at some stage the envy test will not be met. This, however, does not create a problem because the envy test is to be applied diachronically: “it requires that no one envy the bundle of occupation and resources at the disposal of anyone else over time, though someone may envy another’s bundle at any particular time” (1981, 306). Since everyone had the opportunity to work hard it would violate rather than endorse equality of resources if the wealth of the hardworking were from time to time to be distributed to the more leisurely.
d. Talents
The essential reason why differential talents create a problem is that equality of resources at the outset will typically be disturbed, not because of morally acceptable differences in work habits, but because of morally arbitrary differences in talents.
Requiring equality of resources only at the outset would be what Dworkin calls a starting-gate theory of fairness, which Dworkin sees as being “very far from equality of resources” and strongly rejects: “indeed it is hardly a coherent political theory at all”. Such a theory holds that justice requires equality of initial resources, but accepts laissez-faire thereafter. The fundamental problem with a starting-gate theory is that it relies on some purely arbitrary starting point. If the requirement of equality of resources is to apply at one arbitrary point, then presumably it is to apply at other points. If justice requires a Dworkinian auction when the survivors arrive, then it must require such an auction from time to time thereafter; and if justice accepts laissez-faire thereafter, it must accept it when they arrive. Dworkin requires neither that there be periodic auctions nor that there be laissez-faire at all times. His theory does not suppose that an equal division of resources is appropriate at one point in time but not at any other; it argues only that the resources available to someone at any moment be a function of the resources available to or consumed by him at others.
Dworkin’s aim is to specify a scheme that allows the distribution of resources at any point of time to be both ambition-sensitive, in that it reflects the cost or benefit to others of the choices people make, but not be endowment-sensitive, in that it allows scope for differences in ability among people with the same ambitions. To achieve this, Dworkin proposes a hypothetical insurance scheme that is analogous to that for handicaps. In this scheme it is supposed that people know what talents they have, but not the income that these will produce, and choose a level of insurance accordingly. An imaginary agency knows each person’s talents and preferences, and also knows what resources are available and the technology for transforming these into other resources. On the basis of this it computes the income structure, that is, the number of people earning each level of income that will emerge in a competitive market. Each person may buy insurance from the agency to cover the possibility of his income falling below whatever level he cares to name. Dworkin asks “how much of such insurance would the survivors, on average, buy, at what specified level of income coverage, and at what cost?” (1981, 317) and claims that the agency can answer this question.
This, however, is not clear. Consider four very weak requirements of such a scheme: it should distribute resources in such a way that not everyone could be better off under any alternative scheme; an increase in the resources available for allocation should not make anyone worse off; if two people have the same preferences and abilities then they should be allocated the same resources; and the scheme should not damage those whom it seeks to help. As is shown by Roemer, there is in Dworkin’s framework no scheme that satisfies these requirements, so that “resource egalitarianism is an incoherent notion” (1985, 178).
e. Summary
The strength of Dworkin’s equality of resources theory of justice is that it seeks to introduce ambition-sensitivity without allowing endowment-sensitivity. To the extent to which it succeeds in this it thus, in Cohen’s words, incorporates within egalitarianism “the most powerful idea in the arsenal of the anti-egalitarian right: the idea of choice and responsibility” (1989, 933).
However, it is not entirely successful in this endeavour. There are a number of problems with Dworkin’s auction scheme: for example, it is not clear that the auctioneer will ever discover prices at which there is precisely one would-be purchaser for each lot. However, these may be avoided by adopting the intended outcome of the auction, that is, as a free-market outcome in which everyone has the same wealth, as a specification of justice in its own right. But the problems with the insurance scheme are deeper, as Roemer’s argument (presented above) demonstrates.
4. Entitlements
Nozick’s entitlements theory (as an extreme) treats no personal attributes as being arbitrary, and thus defines justice simply as laissez-faire, provided that no one’s rights are infringed. In this view “the complete principle of distributive justice would say simply that a distribution is just if everyone is entitled to the holdings they possess under the distribution” (1974, 151).
a. The Basic Schema
Nozick introduces his approach to “distributive justice” by noting that the term is not a neutral one, but presupposes some central authority that is effecting the distribution. But that is misleading, for there is no such body. Someone’s property holdings are not allocated to her by some central planner: they arise from the sweat of her brow or through voluntary exchanges with, or gifts from, others. There is “no more a distributing or distribution of shares than there is a distributing of mates in a society in which persons choose whom they shall marry” (1974, 150).
Accordingly, Nozick holds that the justice of a state of affairs is a matter of whether individuals are entitled to their holdings. In Nozick’s schema, individuals’ entitlements are determined by two principles, justice in acquisition and justice in transfer:
If the world were wholly just, the following inductive definition would exhaustively cover the subject of justice in holdings.
1. A person who acquires a holding in accordance with the principle of justice in acquisition is entitled to that holding.
2. A person who acquires a holding in accordance with the principle of justice in transfer, from someone else entitled to the holding, is entitled to the holding.
3. No one is entitled to a holding except by (repeated) applications of 1 and 2. (1974, 151)
However, the world may not be wholly just: as Nozick observes, “not all actual situations are generated in accordance with the two principles of justice in holdings”. The existence of past injustice “raises the third major topic under justice in holdings: the rectification of injustice in holdings” (1974, 152).
b. Patterns
Nozick distinguishes entitlement principles of justice from patterned principles. A principle is patterned if “it specifies that a distribution is to vary along with some natural dimension, weighted sum of natural dimensions, or lexicographic ordering of natural dimensions”. A distribution that is determined by peoples’ ages or skin colours, or by their needs or merits, or by any combination of these, is patterned. Nozick claims that “almost every suggested principle of distributive justice is patterned” (1974, 156), where by “almost” he means “other than entitlement principles”.
The fundamental problem with patterned principles is that liberty upsets patterns. As Hume expresses it, “render possessions ever so equal, men’s different degrees of art, care, and industry will immediately break that equality” (1751, 3.2). Nozick argues this using his famous Wilt Chamberlain example.
Suppose that a distribution that is (uniquely) specified as just by some patterned principle of distributive justice is realized: this may be one in which everyone has an equal share of wealth, or where shares vary in any other patterned way. Now there is a basketball player, one Wilt Chamberlain, who is of average wealth but of superior ability. He enters into a contract with his employers under which he will receive 25 cents for each admission ticket sold to see him play. As he is so able a player a million people come to watch him. Accordingly, Mr Chamberlain earns a further $250,000. The question is, is this new distribution, in which Mr Chamberlain is much better off than in the original distribution, and also much better off than the average person, just? One answer must be that it is not, for the new distribution differs from the old, and by hypothesis the old distribution (and only that distribution) was just. On the other hand, the original distribution was just, and people moved from that to the new distribution entirely voluntarily. Mr Chamberlain and his employers voluntarily entered into the contract; all those who chose to buy a ticket to watch Mr Chamberlain play did so voluntarily; and no one else was affected. All holdings under the original distribution were, by hypothesis, just, and people have used them to their advantage: if people were not entitled to use their holdings to their advantage (subject to not harming others) it is not clear why the original distribution would have allocated them any holdings. If the original distribution was just and people voluntarily moved from it to the new distribution then the new distribution must be just.
c. Justice in Acquisition
Acquisition of material is considered to be just if what is acquired is freely available and if acquiring it leaves sufficient material for others. Giving an operational meaning to this requires the specification of what acquisition means, what is freely available, and how leaving sufficient material for others is to be interpreted. In these, Nozick, albeit with reservations, follows Locke.
Locke interprets “acquiring” as “mixing one’s labour with” (1689, 2.5.27). I own my labour, and if I inextricably mix my labour with something that no one else owns then I make that thing my own. However, as Nozick points out (without proposing any resolution of these) there are a number of problems with this interpretation. It is not clear why mixing something that I own with something that I do not own implies that I gain the latter rather than lose the former. In Nozick’s example, “if I own a can of tomato juice and spill it in the sea … do I thereby come to own the sea, or have I foolishly dissipated my tomato juice?” Further, it is not clear what determines how much of the unowned resource I come to own. If I build a fence around a previously unowned plot of land do I own all that I have enclosed, or simply the land under the fence? In Nozick’s example, “if a private astronaut clears a place on Mars, has he mixed his labor with (so that he comes to own) the whole planet, the whole uninhabited universe, or just a particular plot?” (1974, 174-175).
Locke interprets “freely available” as being “in the state that nature hath provided”, and Nozick (without any argument) follows Locke in equating “freely available” with “unowned”. There are however, other possibilities. Virgin resources may be seen as being owned in common, or as being jointly owned in equal shares.
Locke interprets leaving sufficient for others as there being “enough, and as good, left in common for others” (1689, 2.5.27); this is the famous Lockean proviso. There are two possible interpretations of this: I may be made worse off by your appropriating a particular plot of land by no longer being able to appropriate it myself, or by no longer being able to use it. Nozick adopts the second, weaker, version.
d. Justice in Transfer
The essence of Nozick’s principle of justice in transfer is that a transfer is just if it is voluntary, in that each party consents to it. Justice in transfer also involves the satisfaction of the Lockean proviso. This is both indirect and direct. It is indirect in that I cannot legitimately transfer to you something that has been acquired, by me or by anyone else, in violation of the proviso, for that thing is not rightfully mine to transfer. But the proviso is also direct, in that I may not by a series of transfers, each of which is legitimate on its own, acquire property that does not leave enough, and as good, for others.
e. Justice in Rectification
Nozick’s basic schema applies to a world that is “wholly just”. However, the world may not be wholly just: people may have violated the principle of justice in acquisition, for example, by appropriating so much of a thing that an insufficient amount is left for others; or they may have violated the principle of justice in transfer, for example, by theft or fraud. Then, as Nozick observes, “the existence of past injustice (previous violations of the first two principles of justice in holdings) raises the third major topic under justice in holdings: the rectification of injustice in holdings”. Nozick identifies a number of questions that this raises: if past injustice has shaped present holdings in ways that are not identifiable, what should be done; how should violators compensate the victims; how does the position change if compensation is delayed; how, if at all, does the position change if the violators or the victims are no longer living; is an injustice done to someone whose holding which was itself based upon an injustice is appropriated; do acts of injustice lose their force over time; and what may the victims of injustice themselves do to rectify matters? However, these questions are not answered: as Nozick admits, “I do not know of a thorough or theoretically sophisticated treatment of such issues” (1974, 152).
f. Summary
The strength of Nozick’s entitlements theory of justice is that it uncompromisingly respects individual liberty, and thus avoids all the problems associated with patterned approaches to justice. However, by avoiding patterns it introduces its own problems, for in asking how distributions came about, rather than in simply assessing them as they are, Nozick necessarily delves into the mists of time. Here lie the two most significant, and related, problems with Nozick’s theory: that of the relatively unsatisfactory nature of the principle of justice in initial acquisition, and that of the predominantly unexplained means of rectifying any injustice resulting from that.
5. Common Ownership
Common ownership theories in the Steiner-Vallentyne vein treat individuals’ holdings of external resources as arbitrary, but (at least directly) make no adjustments for their preferences or abilities. Such theories are diverse, but they all have in common the basic premise that individuals are full owners of themselves but external resources are owned by society in common. The theories differ in what they consider to be external resources, and in what is entailed by ownership in common.
a. A Framework
Common ownership theories, as entitlement theories, emphasize institutions, or processes, rather than outcomes. In essence, they consider an institution to be just if, firstly, it recognizes the principle of self-ownership and a further principle of liberty which may be called free association, and secondly, it involves some scheme of intervention on the holding or transmission of external resources that results, if not in common ownership itself, in a distribution of resources that shares some of the aspects of common ownership.
The principle of self-ownership, as Cohen’s expresses it, is that “each person enjoys, over herself and her powers, full and exclusive rights of control and use, and therefore owes no service or product to anyone else that she has not contracted to supply” (1995, 12). I have full ownership of myself if I have all the legal rights that someone has over a slave. Since a slaveholder has the legal rights to the labour of his slave and the fruits of that labour, each person is the morally rightful owner of his labour and of the fruits thereof.
The motivation for introducing a principle of free association is that what is legitimate for you and for me should be legitimate for us, subject to the satisfaction of the Lockean proviso (if relevant). Allingham proposes the principle that “each person has a moral right to combine any property to which he is entitled with the (entitled) property of other consenting persons (and share in the benefits from such combination in any manner to which each person agrees) provided that this does not affect any third parties” (2014, 110).
Schemes of intervention on the holding or transmission of property may take the form of absolute restrictions or of taxes on the holding or transfer of property.
b. The Transfer of Property
It might be thought that my rights to my property are empty if they do not permit me to do what I will with it (provided that this does not affect others), and in particular to give it to you. On the other hand, the passing down of wealth through the generations is one of the less intuitively appealing implications of this right. There are three ways of reconciling these two positions: restrictions or taxes on all gifts, on bequests, and on re-gifting.
The first proposal is based on Vallentyne’s claim that the right to transfer property to others does not guarantee that others have an unencumbered right to receive that property, and that, accordingly, the receipt of gifts may legitimately be subject to taxation. This would be to say that (the donor) having control rights in the property, and in particular the right to give it to someone, does not imply (the donee) having income rights in the property, and in particular the unencumbered right to enjoy it.
The motivation underlying the second proposal is, in Steiner’s words, “that an individual’s deserts should be determined by reference to his ancestor’s delinquencies is a proposition which doubtless enjoys a degree of biblical authority, but its grounding in any entitlement conception of justice seems less obvious” (1977, 152). Steiner’s argument in support of this position is that, contrary to Nozick’s view, bequests are fundamentally different to gifts inter vivos. Put simply, dead people do not exist, so cannot make gifts. Accordingly, the recipients of all bequests are to be taxed.
A third proposal is that people have rights to make and receive gifts, but not that these rights last for ever. More precisely, Allingham proposes that a scheme that “adopts the position that each person has a moral right to make any gifts (inter vivos or by bequest) to any other person (which person has a moral right to receive such gifts), but that any gifts that are deemed to be re-gifted may be subject to taxation” (2014, 120). If the gifts a person makes are less than those he receives then the former are deemed to be re-gifted; if the gifts he makes are greater than those he receives then the latter are deemed to be re-gifted. Thus I may freely give to you anything that I have created or earned but not consumed, but if I pass on anything that I myself have been given then this may be taxed.
c. The Holding of Property
Interventions on the holding of property may be seen as falling into three classes. One seeks to impose taxes on land by virtue of the fact that it is God-given, one on all natural resources by virtue of the fact that they are natural, and one on all property by virtue of the fact that it is property.
The claim that land, by natural right, belongs to all, like the claim that a person belongs to himself, is made by Locke: “God … hath given the world to men in common” (1689, 2.5.26). The claim is developed by a number of the nineteenth-century writers, and is most notably associated with George. As any improvements are not due to God it is only unimproved land, not developed land, which is relevant. In a typical contribution scheme proposed by Steiner, each “owner owes to the global fund a sum equal to the site’s rental value, that is, equal to the rental value of the site alone, exclusive of the value of any alterations in it wrought by labour” (1994, 272-273).
Land is not the only natural resource: what other property is to count is not clear. As Steiner notes, in any intervention scheme involving natural resources everything “turns on the isolation of what counts as ‘natural’” (1994, 277). There are many candidates. These, as summarized by Fried, include “gifts and bequests from the preceding generation; all traditional public goods (laws, police force, public works); the community’s physical productive capacity; and well-functioning markets” (2004, 85-86). Under these schemes all natural resources would be taxed in the same way as is land.
There are three possible justifications for taxing property per se: extending the concept of bequests; removing one of the incidents of ownership; and requiring a fee for protection. The first is based on a deemed lack of personal continuity over time: that “I tomorrow” am not the same person as “I today”. If this position is adopted then “I am holding property overnight” really means “I today” am bequeathing property to “I tomorrow”; the property is a bequest not a gift inter vivos as “I today” cease to exist at midnight. The second involves limiting the rights of ownership in external objects, that is, acknowledging only less than full ownership, specifically by excluding the incident of the absence of term, that one’s rights to property do not expire. If the incident of the absence of term is excluded then I have no unencumbered right to continue my ownership in some property from today until tomorrow. If I do so, the state may legitimately require that I pay for that privilege. The third justification distinguishes between the rights to enjoy and to hold through time. The former does not involve the state in any way, other than in non-interference, but the latter may, through the need for protection. If the state is to provide this protection it may legitimately charge a fee for this, and this fee may take the form of a tax on the holding of property.
d. The Social Fund
As common ownership theories typically involve the imposition of taxes, they need to determine how the social fund created by these taxes is to be applied. One natural way to do this is to specify that the social fund be distributed to everyone in equal shares. As an alternative, Nozick, with respect to the case where the social fund is collected explicitly to rectify historical injustices, suggests that the fund be distributed in such a way that the end result is close to Rawls’s difference principle.
A radically different way of dividing the social fund would be to use it to compensate those with unchosen disadvantages, as would be justified, for example, by the argument that such disadvantages were morally arbitrary. There is, however, something perverse about any proposal to apply the social fund in a way that compensates for unchosen personal endowments when all means of collecting the taxes that form that fund have, because of an adherence to the self-ownership principle, ruled out taxing people on that basis. As Fried expresses it, “schemes, which judge the tax and transfer sides of fiscal policy by wholly different distributive criteria, seem morally incoherent” (2004, 90).
e. Summary
The strength of common ownership theories is that, as Fried puts it, they “have staked out a middle ground between the two dominant strains of contemporary political philosophy: the conventional libertarianism of those such as Robert Nozick on the right, and the egalitarianism of those such as Rawls, Dworkin, and Sen on the left” (2004, 67). However, the open question remains as to whether such theories are, in Fried’s terms, “just liberal egalitarianism in drag” (2004, 84).
6. Conclusions
As regards internal consistency, Dworkin’s equality of resources theory may have the greatest problems. Some of the problems with Dworkin’s auction construction may be avoided by adopting its outcome, of an equal wealth equilibrium, as a specification of justice in its own right. The insurance scheme, however, has more serious and unavoidable problems. The fundamental flaw is that shown by Roemer: that no Dworkinian scheme can satisfy four very weak consistency conditions, so that “resource egalitarianism is an incoherent notion”.
Rawlsian justice as fairness fares a little better, but, if it is to be grounded in choice from behind a veil of ignorance, has the serious flaws of that construction. Some of these can be avoided by inessential changes, but other problems are unavoidable, particularly those of identifying the least advantaged (with the related problems of defining primary goods and the construction of an index of these), and of the supposedly rational choice of the maximin principle with its “absurd practical implications”.
Common ownership theories, being diverse, are harder to assess as a group. Theories that involve interventions of the transfer of property have a variety of arbitrariness problems, and typically violate some aspect of the principle of free association. Those that involve interventions on the holding of property have, on the whole, some serious arbitrariness problems, particularly as regards the definition of property.
Nozickian entitlements theory may have the fewest problems of consistency. But although they may be few they are not trivial, particularly those relating to justice in initial acquisition, and to the rectification of past injustice.
It is not clear that it is useful, let alone possible, to identify some most satisfactory theory of justice, and thus identify some most appropriate point in the liberty-equality spectrum. Since self-ownership is a cornerstone of liberty, the problem is given specific focus in Cohen’s claim that “anyone who supports equality of condition must oppose (full) self-ownership, even in a world in which rights over external resources have been equalized” (1995, 72).
In an absolute sense, it seems hard to disagree with Cohen. There may, however, be some room for compromise. From one end of the spectrum, equality of resources moves in that direction, particularly in making Rawlsian egalitarianism more ambition-sensitive without at the same time making it more endowment-sensitive. From the other end, some versions of common ownership also move in that direction. This is particularly the case for versions that embody rectification of past injustice: as Nozick accepts, “although to introduce socialism as the punishment for our sins would be to go too far, past injustices might be so great as to make necessary in the short run a more extensive state in order to rectify them” (1974, 231).
If an accommodation is to be found, it will be found towards the centre of the liberty-equality spectrum, that is, in equality of resources or in common ownership theories. Given the greater internal problems of the former, the latter may prove to be the more fruitful. However, common ownership theories are diverse, so this does not provide a complete prescription. But as Nozick reminds us, “there is room for words on subjects other than last words” (1974, xii).
7. References and Further Reading
a. References
- Allingham, M. (2014) Distributive Justice, London, Routledge.
- Arrow, K. J. (2012) Social Choice and Individual Values (third edition), New Haven: Yale University Press.
- Cohen, G. A. (1989) “On the currency of egalitarian justice”, Ethics, 99: 906-944.
- Cohen, G. A. (1995) Self-Ownership, Freedom, and Equality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Dworkin, R. (1981) “What is equality? Part 2: equality of resources”, Philosophy & Public Affairs 10: 283-345.
- Fried, B. (2004) “Left-libertarianism: a review essay”, Philosophy and Public Affairs, 32: 66–92.
- Hammond, P. J. (1991) “Interpersonal comparisons of utility: why and how they are and should be made”, in Interpersonal Comparisons of Well-Being (editors J. Elster and J. E. Roemer) Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 200-254.
- Harsanyi, J. (1977) “Morality and the theory of rational behavior”, Social Research, 44; reprinted in Utilitarianism and Beyond (editors A. Sen and B. Williams) Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 39-62.
- Hume, D. (1751/1998) An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, edited by T. L. Beauchamp, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Locke, J. (1689/1988) Two Treatises of Government, edited by P. Laslett, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Nozick, R. (1974) Anarchy, State, and Utopia, Oxford: Blackwell.
- Rawls, J. (1999) A Theory of Justice (revised edition), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Rawls, J. (2005) Political Liberalism (expanded edition), New York: Columbia University Press.
- Roemer, J. E. (1985) “Equality of talent”, Economics and Philosophy, 1: 151-187.
- Roemer, J. E. (1996) Theories of Distributive Justice, Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press.
- Sandel, M. J. (2009) Justice: What’s the Right Thing to Do?, Allen Lane: London.
- Scanlon, T. (1991) “The moral basis of interpersonal comparisons”, in Interpersonal Comparisons of Well-Being (editors J. Elster and J. E. Roemer) Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 17-44.
- Steiner, H. (1977) “Justice and entitlement”, Ethics, 87: 150-152
- Steiner, H. (1994) An Essay on Rights, Cambridge, MA: Blackwell.
b. Further Reading
- Overviews
- Vallentyne, P. (2007) “Distributive justice”, in A Companion to Contemporary Political Philosophy (editors R. Goodin, P. Pettit, and T. Pogge), Oxford: Blackwell, 548-562.
- Wellman, C. H. (2002) “Justice”, in The Blackwell Guide to Social and Political Philosophy (edited by R. L. Simon), Oxford: Blackwell.
- Justice as fairness
- Freeman, S. (editor) (2003) The Cambridge Companion to Rawls, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Equality of resources
- Brown, A. (2009) Ronald Dworkin’s Theory of Equality, London: Macmillan.
- Entitlements
- Bader R. M. and Meadowcroft J. (editors) (2011) The Cambridge Companion to Nozick’s Anarchy, State, and Utopia, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Common ownership
- Vallentyne, P. and Steiner, H. (editors) (2000) Left Libertarianism and Its Critics: The Contemporary Debate, Basingstoke: Palgrave.
Author Information
Michael Allingham
Email: michael.allingham@magd.ox.ac.uk
Oxford University
United Kingdom