Scientism

Scientism is often rendered as the view that all real knowledge is scientific knowledge. According to its advocates, science’s distinctive successes make it the best or only way to know, and non-scientific claims must therefore be rejected, downgraded or held in abeyance.

It seems obvious that modern science is a powerful and successful mode of inquiry whose applications are nearly limitless. Scientism leverages this widespread esteem for science into a more specific view that a) endorses that science is the uniquely successful form of knowing, and b) consequently devalues or excludes non-scientific claims.

Scientism should not be confused with science itself. Defenders of scientism are not necessarily scientists, and critics of scientism are not necessarily critics of science. Scientism is a philosophical view about science that need not correlate with any particular scientific activities.

Scientism might be employed, for example, to disparage ideas deemed unscientific: a critic might claim that belief in moral goodness, consciousness, or God is not scientific and therefore not credible. If that belief is not grounded in contemporary science, perhaps it is merely sentiment, dogma, or wishful thinking.

Scientism comes in many varieties; in its strongest forms it poses sweeping implications for each of the major subdivisions within philosophy – ethics, metaphysics, and epistemology. Strong scientism suggests the meta-ethical conclusion that there are no facts about right or wrong because science has not disclosed any. Some strong forms of scientism make short work of ontology: what exists is just what contemporary sciences postulate. In the theory of knowledge, scientism suggests that science is the embodiment of successful inquiry and therefore instantiates the proper way to know, namely scientific methods. Such conclusions have led some proponents of scientism to proclaim that philosophy is over and that it has been eclipsed by science.

Despite its appeal to some, “scientism” is frequently a pejorative label for a problematic view that has gone beyond what is demonstrated by science itself and into the realm of a tendentious philosophical belief–or even an ideology–about science. Indeed, the term is most often used derogatively, and scientism’s explicit defenders are few in number. To its detractors, scientism represents a naïve faith in science’s philosophical significance, an overestimation of science’s real value, and a premature dismissal of legitimate non-scientific discourses.

If scientism has few explicit defenders, one might naturally wonder whether it is a meaningful philosophical concept worthy of sustained study. One reason to answer in the affirmative is that scientism has saturated many discourses about science, so it may be present, even if it is not always recognized. It has been suggested that scientism is so pervasive that it has become a “new orthodoxy” and “de facto world-view of the academy” (Williams 2015, Hutchinson 2011). Some of the most potent ideas are ones whose ubiquity can hide the recognition that they are contestable philosophical ideas at all. The capacity to recognize, label, and understand them is therefore a worthy endeavor.

Terminology: Some Senses of Scientism
Some Sources of Scientism
Defenses of Scientism
Critiques of Scientism
References and Further Reading

1.Terminology: Some Senses of Scientism

It is difficult to attach one precise definition to scientism, for several reasons. First, scientism has few explicit adherents – though to be sure there are some who claim it as a badge of honor. Consequently, scientism is often defined (and targeted) by critics, who may not always charitably represent the most defensible forms of scientism. Second, it has a murky intellectual history. Even if impulses toward scientism can be recognized in the history of philosophy, they rarely traveled under a particular banner or label.

The English word “scientism” only gained widespread use in the mid-20^th century. One likely influence is Austrian economist Friedrich Hayek, who theorized “scientism” as the fascination with the particular tools of natural sciences and an imitation of their techniques and vocabularies even in areas of study where they may not fit (1942, 268). Social scientists, Hayek believed, should adapt their methods of study to the particular problems they investigated, but he worried that growing esteem for the “hard sciences” was graduating to an unreflective insistence that their methods were the best or only methods. For Hayek, this was a problem because it restricted the toolkits of social scientists to those used by physicists, chemists, and biologists.

Since Hayek’s early diagnosis and critique, the term has gained popularity and also proliferated into a variety of senses. While the formulations below are each explicit philosophical theses, the ensuing discussion considers what other kinds of claims scientism might be. Here are a few of the various ways it has been construed (for more extensive “conceptual maps” see Stenmark 2001 and Peels 2018):

Scientism 1: Scientific knowledge is the only form of knowledge. This so-called “strong scientism” effectively excludes all other putative knowledge claims and thereby significantly restricts the scope of human understanding only to the deliverances of science. As with other forms of scientism, it gets its bite largely by what it demotes or excludes, which in this case is substantial.

Scientism 2: Scientific knowledge is the best form of knowledge. “Weaker” versions of scientism do not seek to banish all non-scientific claims but only hold this realm in lower esteem than scientific claims. Like the version above, this is an epistemic formulation concerning the distinctively superior character of scientific knowledge. These versions might admit that non-scientific endeavors have their own value – for example that philosophy could provide a form of understanding even if that understanding does not have the same status as knowledge.

Scientism 3: Science can resolve all questions. This sense of scientism emphasizes the expansive intellectual territory that properly belongs within the scope of science. This sense claims that if a question is meaningful, it is within the capacity of science to answer the question: science is limitless (Atkins 1995). This sense may need to be construed hypothetically: at least in theory, all questions can be resolved by science – though it may often require stronger, better sciences of the future to do so. In any case, this sense regards non-scientific claims as at best tentative placeholders for more secure answers forthcoming from science. Finally, this sense of scientism supports a particular view of scientific progress by which science advances by sloughing off the remnants of philosophy: what might begin as philosophical speculation matures into “hard” empirical science with real answers (Reichenbach 1951).

Scientism 4: This sense focuses on the value or worth of science. According to major scholarly studies, scientism is “putting too high a value on science in comparison with other branches of learning or culture” (Sorell 1991, x) or “an exaggerated kind of deference towards science” (Haack 2003, 17). A related sense of scientism might take for granted the value of science, rather than recognizing its worth as one value among others which may be adopted or rejected. (Brown 2020, 126). Such enthusiasm could suggest that science is an absolute good. On that view, knowing scientific truth is intrinsically valuable and the pursuit of knowledge is incumbent upon a rational person even if that pursuit conflicts with other goods.

Scientism 5: Ontological scientism insists that what exists is only those entities posited by science. If it has not been discovered by science, then it cannot be real. This is closely connected with philosophical commitments known as materialism or physicalism. Often, it will prioritize the entities of fundamental physics or neurobiology, suggesting a reality behind the (misleading) appearance. This sense of scientism often gets traction in its application to human beings: it might suggest that humans are nothing but an aggregation of water and organic molecules and use that to argue against, for example, free will or some other purported capacity.

Scientism 6: A somewhat distinct sense of the term is that science provides conclusive guidance to action. Science can yield the most rational policy recommendations because science alone generates justified conclusions. While people may have a range of views based on their (merely) political sensibilities, rational policymakers would “follow the science.” The aspiration for science to be useful for society was part of the founding ideals for modern science, and it has since been connected to a variety of political programs, ranging from technocracy to utopian idealism to apocalyptic political realism.

The distinctive senses of scientism each have implications for their tenability, the details of which are beyond the scope of this article. For the purposes of this article, we do not need to insist it is an erroneous view, or adhere to just one definition, and a few generalizations may be permitted about their shared aspects. Scientism elevates science and deprecates non-science. That is to say, the distinctive powers of science grant some measure of exclusivity about what can count as credible or real, favoring scientific over non-scientific accounts. Scientism is typically a philosophy about knowledge but might easily graduate into a more comprehensive worldview, bearing on religion, morality, and politics. Scientism invites the possibility that all problems, including human problems, are fundamentally akin to technological problems which can be solved with further science. Scientism is often both reductionistic and expansive: it reduces the world’s complexities into those which science can illuminate yet supposes that science is the best or only tool for all inquiry. And scientism sometimes supposes that science provides the best or even conclusive guidance to action.

2. Some Sources of Scientism

Historically, scientism has been less of a specific doctrine than a diffuse impulse to deeply respect or revere science. By the 19^th century, such veneration was so culturally widespread that many famous works of art recognized and criticized it: Romantic poet William Blake decried the “single vision” that was an impoverished worldview based only on Newtonian science, and novelists from Dickens to Dostoevsky excoriated what they took to be a cultural piety and article of faith. Accordingly, scientism may not have a discrete intellectual history. This section cannot therefore trace anything like the development of a doctrine. Instead, it will highlight a few historical inflections that lend themselves to scientistic impulses.

A theme in this cursory review is that the practices and ideas emerging from the 17^th century “Scientific Revolution” were recognized as uniquely valuable; as enthusiasm for those sciences grew they were adopted as a model for many other forms of inquiry and then also as a standard by which to judge or exclude endeavors that did not fit into their supposed strictures.

a. A Single Method and Intellectual Optimism

Taking a step back from explicit debates over scientism, one might identify, in the broad sweep of history, a precondition for scientism in the view that all knowledge has a single procedure or method, rather than coming in discrete varieties. An ancient philosophical tradition, dating from Aristotle, had supposed that different methods were needed to investigate different topics. Because nature operated through a variety of causes, inquiry must be suited to the causes themselves. Transferring a single method from one topic to another would amount to a category mistake (Livesey 1985). For Aristotle, this was likely a pointed criticism directed toward his teacher Plato, who utilized math as a kind of universal method.

Early Modern philosophy was distinctive for this breakdown of discrete categories of knowledge, and a resulting fusion of knowledge claims often combining scientific, metaphysical, and theological dimensions (Funkenstein 1986). One of the striking hallmarks of 17^th century philosophers was a pronounced concern that real knowledge could only be secured by adherence to the correct method. To take one prominent example, in his attempt to overcome the challenge of philosophical skepticism, Descartes advanced a powerful epistemology that imagined true knowledge arising from disciplined attention to the correct method. This methodical approach to the creation of a uniform science applied mechanical principles to (nearly) everything, and Descartes was optimistic about its powers. He claimed to use this method to make novel discoveries about metaphysics, physics, and medicine “in order to show that the method extends to every kind of subject-matter” (Descartes 1985, 109). The Cartesian ideal of a single method of inquiry therefore provided epistemic foundations for all knowledge ranging from the scientific to the theological. All that could be known, he supposed, could be known via the correct method. From our present point of view, when science is often considered archetypical knowledge, we might discern how this Early Modern fusion of knowledge into one sort of thing paved the way for scientistic sentiment. It is harder to claim there is one sort of knowledge when you recognize many discrete categories of inquiry with their own legitimacy.

Moreover, those who suppose that human cognitive powers can attain a more or less complete grasp of reality are more likely to support scientism. Descartes hypothesizes a world in which there is “absolutely nothing that everyone cannot know as perfectly as possible” (1985, 90), and perhaps in a similarly optimistic spirit, a modern defender of scientism asks, “why should anything remain obscure” from scientific illumination (Atkins 2011, x)?

b. Empiricism and the Exclusion of Religion and Metaphysics

The “new sciences” or “mechanical philosophy” that arose from the 17^th century Scientific Revolution had a complex relationship with religion: sometimes science was advanced as the best means of support for religion, and at other times it was taken to be the most potent solvent of religion.

The desire to pursue natural knowledge in the Middle Ages and Renaissance was often linked to the perception that science would complement the revealed knowledge central to the religious traditions of Judaism, Christianity, and Islam and thereby serve as the “handmaiden” of theology. Many natural philosophers claimed that they studied nature in order to better understand its ultimate source. Natural philosophy was often both practically and theoretically useful for theological ends and was pursued with passion. Seventeenth-century polymath Robert Boyle, for example, held that scientific experimentation should be permitted even on the sabbath, despite being a kind of labor, since discerning God’s creation amounted to a spiritual exercise (Davis 2007).

Yet even passionate esteem for science, on its own, does not graduate into scientism without an additional negative thesis – some component of scientific imperialism, exclusivity, or the replacement of non-science. Therefore, one way to look for historical bases of scientism is to look for claims that science might replace or undo some other type of belief. The beliefs most often challenged by scientism – ironically, given religion’s central role supporting the origins of modern science – are religious beliefs. According to one scholar, “scientism gains its highest public profile… and virtually defines itself, when it attacks the institution that has, more than any other, made use of and fostered poetry, art, music, aesthetics, and arguably science itself – namely, religion” (Principe 2015). It is ironic because many of the progenitors of modern science, including Kepler, Descartes, Newton, and Boyle, not only adhered strongly to religious beliefs of their own but understood their theological commitments as foundational to their scientific pursuits (Henry 2010, Gaukroger 2006).

One well-known instance of the exclusionary impulse arises from Scottish philosopher David Hume’s commitments to empiricism, the view that knowledge arises from sensory experience, and his sense of what falls outside the scope of empirical knowledge. Hume was skeptical that metaphysical claims about God, minds, causes, free will, and much else could be established via the empirical processes he believed were the cornerstone of real knowledge. He harkened back to the pioneering work of Francis Bacon who a century earlier had advocated a scientific method of cautious extrapolations rooted in experimental observation. Hume took Bacon’s experimental philosophy as the only kind of knowledge worth having and made it the basis for claims about nature and human nature.

For Hume, this skeptical empiricism had sweeping – and damning – consequences for a great deal of philosophy and theology: “If we take in our hand any volume; of divinity or school metaphysics, for instance; let us ask, does it contain any abstract reasoning concerning quantity or number? No. Does it contain any experimental reasoning concerning matter of fact and existence? No. Commit it then to the flames: for it can contain nothing but sophistry and illusion” (Hume 2007, 120).

Modern defenses of scientism continue to be animated by concerns over the status of metaphysics and especially religion, and a recurring theme is their suggestion that whole swathes of intellectual or spiritual endeavor may be so faulty as to warrant “committing to the flames.”

c. A Scientific Society

A distinctive thread of scientism imagines that science is the cornerstone of a rational and progressive society, because commitment to science characterizes modern society, and because only science, in turn, discloses how society works and how to improve it. This sentiment may often undergird the sense that scientific policies are the best policies, as in sense 6 above. A trio of successive thinkers, each a pioneer of the social sciences, illustrate how science came to be seen as the foundation of civilizational progress.

Marquis de Condorcet articulated a powerful vision of social progress that was tightly linked to scientific enlightenment. Having made foundational contributions to mathematics earlier in his career, Condorcet exhibited the quintessential aim of Enlightenment philosophes to apply natural knowledge in the service of social reform. While in hiding from the Reign of Terror in 1793-4, he wrote an important essay postulating distinct stages of social development with a yet-unrealized final stage near at hand. It was a social history of improvement from humankind’s earliest crude social associations to its contemporary civilized refinements. In purging scientific errors, he argued, we also correct philosophical, moral, and political errors that are based on them. In this way, scientific advance yields political progress. Condorcet was profoundly optimistic about this process: the production, dissemination, and implementation of knowledge would be affected on such a scale that even human nature would be altered for the better. A mutually reinforcing cycle of scientific knowledge and social reform would generate increasingly enlightened public opinion and a secure basis for democracy. These improvements would continue indefinitely because “the perfectibility of man is truly indefinite” (1955, 4).

Henri de Saint-Simon adopted Condorcet’s sense of historical progress and extended it into a more programmatic socialism specifically addressing the inequalities generated by the industrial revolution. Saint-Simon offered a picture of science’s historical development from conjecture and speculation to mature “positive” science – “positive” in his sense meaning facts which have been observed and analyzed (1952, 21). This progressive development had taken root in astronomy and chemistry and would soon apply to the study of humans too, as a “science of man.” Saint-Simon thought that all phenomena, physical and mental alike, were explicable via physical laws, so the history of humans is susceptible to scientific analysis just like the orbits of planets. In this way he fashioned history as deterministic and to some extent predictable, as Karl Marx and later socialists would as well. His scientific analysis of society extended to religion too. Saint-Simon was one of the early theorists to consider religion as the attempt to organize empirical experience – essentially as proto-science. Framed this way, it becomes easy to dismiss traditional religion as outdated and in need of better scientific foundations – foundations which Saint-Simon began forging himself and which he dubbed “New Christianity.”

Just like his predecessors, Auguste Comte shared the general aspiration of the French Revolution to replace a theologically-grounded monarchy with a secular society serving the public good. Comte theorized a new empirical study of society he baptized “sociology” whose insights would lead to a scientific reorganization of society. He adopted the name “positive” science partly from Saint-Simon, for whom he worked as secretary, and Comte called his philosophical-political program “positivism.” Comte believed in the essentially spiritual dimension of social cohesion and developed his own novel atheistic religion to address it. A core tenet of positivism was that the only valid method of attaining knowledge is that used in the natural sciences – a view near the heart of contemporary formulations of scientism. Comte developed an influential three-part division of social progress based on characteristic forms of human understanding. The initial theological stage involves attributing anomalous phenomena to deities; a transitional metaphysical stage replaces supernatural deities with abstract philosophical concepts; and a third positive stage is characterized by a scientific spirit, acknowledging that the causal questions of the previous stages cannot be answered but finally arriving at concrete facts that will be useful for human needs (Martineau 1868, 25-30). (Such typologies of social progress, which became common in the 19^th century, typically assumed that Europe was at the forefront of this march forward, sometimes with overtly racist underpinnings.)

As is clear from these examples, French intellectuals at this time had a surprising appetite for fashioning new religions: Revolutionary fervor led to the Cult of Reason and Cult of the Supreme Being, Saint-Simon’s New Christianity became a part of his acolytes’ “Saint-Simonism,” and Comte pioneered a “Religion of Humanity” complete with an elaborate liturgy (Wernick 2001). All these new religious movements were premised on the sense that society had outgrown traditional Christianity, but that ritual devotion nevertheless offered something remedial, such as stabilizing common beliefs or moral precepts, or combatting the spiritual emptiness of lives dedicated to individual self-interest. Some of these short-lived religious experiments venerated figures like Isaac Newton or placed the most learned scientists as custodians of spiritual guidance: in such cases, scientists literally became priests, prophets, or saints for a modern age.

But the fashion for new religions did not last long, and social theorists were soon arguing something else: that modernization correlated with decreased participation in traditional religions. This “secularization thesis” became a centerpiece of social theory and suggested an inverse relationship between social progress and religious piety. This only reinforced the sense, for some, that science and religion were in tension with one another – a view that later fed into a potent narrative about the conflict of religion and science (Taylor 2007, Brooke 2010).

d. A Scientific Philosophy

Logical positivism (also called logical empiricism) was a heterogeneous movement that adopted Comte’s enthusiasm and nomenclature for “positive” science (but see Uebel 2013). Initially rooted in 1920s Vienna, the logical positivists, many of whom had first-hand experience in science, sought to make sense of the spectacular progress of math and physics of the period, especially Einstein’s relativity theories, and contrasted that progress with what they thought was the doleful state of contemporary philosophy. As empiricists they were skeptical of what they considered the abstract and imprecise metaphysics of, for example, Hegelian attempts to grapple with the ultimate nature of reality.

Closely connected with their intellectual aspirations to capture a “spirit of enlightenment” (as they put it in their manifesto advocating “the scientific world-conception”) was a political program to coordinate and use the sciences – including social science – to reform society following the crises of World War I. Otto Neurath, for example, concentrated on economic reform, cooperative housing policy, and adult education, each of which involved cultivating and applying social knowledge to improve living conditions (Cartwright et al. 2008). The philosophical currents they most opposed were ones sometimes used to support Nazi propaganda. Unsurprisingly for a group that included Jews, socialists, and advocates of evidence-based policies, logical positivists were persecuted by Hitler’s Third Reich, and their dispersal to Europe and North America exerted profound influence on the development of “analytic philosophy” in the 20^th century (Reisch 2005).

In their study of the logical and linguistic aspects of knowledge, an important doctrine of logical positivism was the “verifiability criterion of meaning” according to which empirical statements were only meaningful insofar as they could be confirmed, at least in principle, by observation or experiment. In other words, one must be able to stipulate what method would be used to tell if a statement was true or false. Positivists generally thought many scientific statements passed this test (though there were borderline cases, such as generalizations and laws) while the more opaque claims of philosophy did not. If some statement failed this test, that indicated it was not even false – it was even worse, meaningless, and for some members, was dismissed as “nonsense.” This criterion ostensibly swept away most of metaphysics, theology, and ethics. When pressed about how to analyze the moral claims that seem so central to our experience – claims like, “it is wrong to steal” – some positivists suggested this was merely the expression of preference or emotion: something like, “boo, stealing” – a view later called “emotivism” (Ayer 1952, chaps. I and VI).

Logical positivists often conceived the job of philosophy as clarifying claims about the world – claims which properly originated from science. Philosophy, then, was “an activity not a doctrine.” That is to say, it did not make knowledge claims of its own but was a second-order activity, sometimes called “metascientific,” not about the world but about language about the world.

Many contemporary advocates of scientism, whatever their views on the precise status of philosophy, likewise give pride of place to science to speak about the world and similarly lump together many claims deemed unscientific (such as metaphysical or moral claims) as deeply confused, emotive, or just “nonsense.”

3. Defenses of Scientism

Many thinkers have defended a reverence for the accomplishments of science, along with a sense of science’s special connections with rationality or progress. These widespread sensibilities graduate into scientism when they demote ideas, practices, or fields of study considered non-scientific.

a. The Only Game in Town

Due to the typically pejorative connotation of the word, explicit defenses of scientism are rare. Much more often, some argument is pressed in the name of science which a critic might label scientistic. A common dynamic is that one thinker will explicate what they believe science shows, while a critic might point out its oversimplification, perhaps excavating the suppressed (or even unrecognized) philosophical, historical, ethical, or theological assumptions involved in that argument. For example, one author argues that science shows there can be no such thing as free will, because the variety of factors with some influence on behavior (neurons, genes, epigenetics, etc.) add up to an overall picture in which there is no space left for agency (Sapolsky 2023). At least one critic labels the argument quintessentially scientistic insofar as it mistakes a philosophical topic like free will for an empirical hypothesis (Riskin 2025, see also Northcott 2019).

The defender of the purportedly scientistic view is sometimes explicit that the scientific results are the only ones worth taking seriously, or as philosopher Daniel Dennett once put it, “when it comes to fact… science is the only game in town” (Byrnes 2006). Sapolsky, for example, writes that determinism is the scientific view of the world, and considers ideas about human agency as “magical,” “absurd,” “mystical gibberish,” and “nonsense.” In other cases, it is not just specific topics like free will that are discounted but entire disciplines: “What is the nature of reality? Where did all this come from? Did the universe need a creator?… Traditionally these are questions for philosophy, but philosophy is dead. Philosophy has not kept up with modern developments in science, particularly physics. Scientists have become the bearers of the torch of discovery in our quest for knowledge” (Hawking and Mlodinow 2010, 5, see more such examples in Pigliucci 2017).

The sentiment that scientific claims are the only ones worth taking seriously is often assumed rather than argued; the fact that it often passes with little argument gives some evidence as to its prevalence, especially in popular science writing (de Ridder 2014). Philosopher Mary Midgley refers to this widespread mindset as a social “myth” – a thought pattern or imaginative vision about the “omnicompetence” of science (2001, 2004). Theorizing its status as mythic might help explain how scientism travels less as a specific philosophical thesis than as a cultural touchstone that sometimes passes for common wisdom.

b. Comparative Superiority

All that said, there is an increasingly robust body of literature defending scientism by those who find it attractive and seek to rescue the term from its pejorative connotation. One author defends the superiority of scientific over non-scientific disciplines by arguing that scientific disciplines produce more knowledge and more impactful knowledge, as measured by number of publications and citations (Mizrahi 2017). And in surveys, contemporary academic philosophers are more likely to respond that scientific disciplines make progress than do non-scientific disciplines (Mizrahi 2023). Insofar as disciplinary progress indicates superiority, such data suggests sciences may be superior to philosophy.

Other versions of weak scientism claim that there are no ways of knowing apart from the sciences broadly construed. Many of the complications reside in just how broadly sciences are construed since, interpreted too broadly, “scientism” becomes trivial. If scientific methods are not uniquely special, but merely refinements of ordinary ways of knowing, then the practices of science would seem of a piece with many other practices. At least one author suggests that history and the humanities, along with everyday commonsense knowledge, should be included under this “broad construal” of science because they all use “methods that are … continuous with science,” while other pursuits, such as theology, are simply “too detached from science” (Boudry 2017, 47).

Philosopher Rik Peels (2017) argues that the best prospects for a defensible scientism lie with the potential for science to undermine commonsense beliefs, for example if neuroscientific or evolutionary explanations show that moral beliefs are thoroughly illusory. While science has made some suggestive inroads here, he notes that such results remain under debate.

c. Scientism as Stance

The philosophical tradition of naturalism typically understands the job of philosophy to hew closely to the sciences, for it is only the sciences which disclose the constituents of nature, and there exists nothing beyond nature. Scientism can be formulated as a strict (or restrictive) version of naturalism. In their attack against analytic metaphysics, one research group has developed and defended an avowedly scientistic perspective that combines a) empiricism, b) naturalism, and c) “naturalistic closure,” meaning any metaphysical claim must be related to fundamental physics, which they take to hold primacy over all other sciences. One philosopher has labeled this kind of scientism a “stance” – that is, not just a factual claim, but something that also includes attitudes, commitments, values, goals, or approaches (Ladyman and Ross 2007, Ladyman 2011). A stance is not a straightforward claim about what is the case, but something more like a strategy for belief-formation, and so is a distinctive order of claim in addition to specific doctrines or myths, discussed above.

d. “New Atheism” and Strong Scientism

A loosely-affiliated group dubbed “New Atheists” rose to prominence in the early 2000s with aggressive assertions that science undermines faith traditions. While atheism is of course an ancient doctrine, this group joined a modern tradition emphasizing what they take to be science’s destructive powers over traditional culture, particularly religion. Philosophers have noted the scientistic dimensions of this movement (Pigliucci 2013).

Philosopher Alex Rosenberg extends (or rebrands) such atheism into a bracing version of strong scientism – “the conviction that the methods of science are the only reliable ways to secure knowledge of anything; that science’s description of the world is correct in its fundamentals; and that when ‘complete,’ what science tells us will not be surprisingly different from what it tells us today” (2011, 6). What science tells us today, according to Rosenberg, is that “physics is the whole truth about reality,” that there is no meaning of life, that there is no soul or free will or God, that there is no difference between right and wrong, and that history, biography, literature, and the humanities are all deeply confused products of the brain’s evolved preference for narrative (2011, 2, 20, 207-212). The basis of Rosenberg’s confidence in science is that the institutions of science are fallible, meaning scientists check, refine, and improve upon their claims in an error-reducing fashion (20). Interestingly, for Rosenberg, veneration for science can extend too far if one supposes that science is not just the only way to know, but itself the summum bonum – the highest good or an absolute good. Richard Dawkins reports that “science is one of the supreme things that makes life worth living” (cited in Rosenberg 2011, 278) but Rosenberg calls this view a “misty-eyed” “delusion” that simply substitutes science for religion.

e. Scientifically Based Politics

The aspiration to use science to reform and improve society was part of the guiding ideals of modern science; Francis Bacon even penned a utopian tale in which upstanding scientific experts enjoy state support for generating useful knowledge. Just as medical practitioners hope to draw upon their best “evidence-based” knowledge, the idea here is that public decision-makers should likewise implement evidence-based policies. While this framing is not scientistic, and appears unproblematic, such sentiments sometimes coexist uneasily alongside liberal political ideals that are broadly permissive of all kinds of input, not just scientific. (This can be destructive in cases when science is corroded by disinformation or ideology – for example regarding the health effects of tobacco smoke or the mechanisms of climate change (Oreskes and Conway 2010).

The scientistic dimension of policymaking arises if scientific authority is taken as the guide to decision-making, minimizing other political concerns. One remarkable episode in the identification of and adherence to rationality took place in the fraught era of nuclear brinkmanship, when a group of scientists collaborated around their view that rationality involved the automatic implementation of algorithmic rules (Erickson et al. 2013). Contrary to the view that rationality involves practical wisdom (as Aristotle called it) or discretionary judgment (in a Kantian vein), these scientists were impressed by novel calculating tools that they hoped would replace such tacit judgments. Game theory, conflict resolution models, and linear programming were a few of the formal developments in “the human sciences” that spurred their efforts to decipher reason and implement its dictates – some of which became policies of the US Government in its various strategies of nuclear deterrence.

Around the same time, the most influential proponent of behaviorist psychology, B.F. Skinner, applied his research program (positing that autonomy was illusory and behavior was the inevitable product of rewards and punishments) to social contexts, both in his utopian fiction Walden Two and in several real-life communes. Elsewhere Skinner expounded his vision of cultural engineering through “technologies of behavior” that overcome the “prescientific” illusion of human agency, harnessing the environmental dictates of our behaviors to reform society, for example to ameliorate what he considered the crisis of overpopulation (1971).

f. Historical Context Matters

While philosophers typically evaluate ideas abstractly, it is important to keep in mind that expressions of scientism are often reactions to local historical and political contexts. Scientistic work sometimes emerges in response to situations when scientific rationality is thought to be under threat. For example, a heated academic battle in the 1990s known as “The Science Wars” registered scientistic discourse in response to a wave of cultural studies of science, which were sometimes perceived as relativist left-wing attacks on the status of science. Likewise, the September 11 terrorist attacks and ensuing “War on Terror” were the immediate occasion for Sam Harris’ lament of religious extremism, which manifested in an important (2004) book attacking all religions as irrational and arguably inaugurating a “New Atheist” movement.

4. Critiques of Scientism

a. Implausibility and Logical Circularity

Some philosophers believe that scientism – at least in some formulations – is untenable on its face. To claim, for example, that I know my toddler likes to be tickled, and that such knowledge is clearly not scientific knowledge, seems to conflict with the sentiment of strong scientism that there is no genuine knowledge outside of scientific methods.

Philosophers have also criticized scientism as logically fallacious. The claim that science is the only (or even best) form of knowledge is not an empirical result of any science, but rather a philosophical commitment. Therefore, scientism itself is not grounded in science and by its own lights could not be genuinely known (van Woudenberg 2023). Discussions about the nature or value of science draw essentially on philosophy, history, politics, and perhaps other non-scientific modes of analysis, so it is possibly fallacious if this category is then used to generate the conclusion that all real knowledge is scientific knowledge. (This criticism might be less of a problem for those who defend scientism as a stance.)

b. Demarcating Science from Non-science

Scientism requires a distinction between science and non-science. (If there is no such distinction and “science” is used so broadly as to mean “reasonable thinking” then perhaps scientism is trivially true.) However, extended efforts to find such a distinction have proved elusive. The attempt to define science, or demarcate it from non-science, has a significant history in 20^th century Anglophone philosophy. Philosophers such as Karl Popper and Imre Lakatos spurred a sophisticated body of literature aimed at characterizing science and therefore distinguishing it from more dubious non-scientific claims. Popper employed a “falsificationist” standard to separate real science from pseudo-science (2002). Lakatos used a more historically sensitive standard of successful “progressive research programs” to characterize real science (1978). Yet these noteworthy attempts to define science are typically seen as unfulfilled. It is not the case that all activities labeled scientific share any definitive method, standards, or ontologies. The history of science is replete with examples of scientists whose steadfast commitment to theories – even ones that seem to have been falsified – eventually bear fruit. Philosophers’ attempts at neatly defining science have not meshed easily with the unruly history of scientific inquiry, which does not bear easy lessons for what “real” science is supposed to be (Feyerabend 2010, Laudan 1983). The advocate of scientism faces a burden of explanation to characterize science, but such a task is problematized by this inconclusive search.

But if scientism requires a demarcation, it is worth noting that many critics of scientism also lean on a demarcation insofar as they formulate scientism as the illegitimate trespass on non-scientific territory. The critic of scientism who wants to “keep science in its lane” implicitly defines non-scientific topics which can only be wrongly intruded upon by science. Debates about scientism therefore continue to grapple with unresolved questions about how exactly to characterize science – a task arguably at the very heart of scientism debates (Pigliucci 2017, Turunen et al. 2023).

c. Distorting Science

Such difficulties defining science are not always well taken by proponents of scientism, who sometimes describe science as a well-delineated style of inquiry, bearing a clear genealogical relationship to the values and standards that emerged in a 17^th century Scientific Revolution and spread throughout Enlightenment Europe (Pinker 2013). This historical framing, grouping together a wide variety of thinkers all under the single banner of “science,” risks distorting science and therefore foreclosing genuine understanding of actual science in its many varieties. It also tends to minimize the philosophical tensions among those very natural philosophers said to have generated modern science.

Many influential studies of science have highlighted the variegated activities that could all legitimately travel under the banner of science, problematizing the notion that they have any unique method or essence in common (Hacking 1996). Philosophers have also argued that different sciences reveal very different (but equally legitimate) perspectives on the world, and that there is no one “master discipline” with universal scope or authority over others (Cartwright 1999, Dupré 1993). Moreover, sciences generally work through the adoption of significant background assumptions and idealizations, constraints which enable empirical progress but which are not shared across different research programs (Potochnik 2017). Reifying this variety of activities as “Science” may therefore be a mistake. Scientism risks flattening a rich assortment of activities into a single homogenous thing.

But if science is a collection of activities and not a single “thing” then that removes some of the rhetorical power of scientism, which often gains its appeal by tethering together an assortment of especially successful scientific results and contrasting them with some trends one finds problematic.

Perhaps the grossest distortion of science is an elision of science with its object of study, nature itself. But it is simply a category mistake to imagine that science is a transparent window into reality. Science is the human attempt to understand, predict, and control the natural world, and in that basic sense, is a human construction no less than art history or music composition (Smith 2015). Entire fields are devoted to the analysis of scientific practices, but one very basic point is that science exists within the realm of culture, not nature.

d. Science Is Not Just Science

Most sciences involve a complex network of judgments that is partly philosophical. Even if scientific data is taken as unproblematic, understanding its significance is arguably always an act of interpretation – broadly speaking, an act of philosophizing. Interpretive frameworks to make sense of data are often shared in common by a community of researchers, and may remain unquestioned for a time, but for all that, they are not given, obvious, or objectively true in the way that that a simple measurement might be true. Consider some basic questions scientists must implicitly answer: What topics are worth investigating? What kinds or types of entities does their inquiry invoke? Is some phenomena a cause or an effect? What theories will they draw upon? How does their inquiry fit or not fit with other scientific claims? Even something as basic as statistical significance, often viewed as a mere calculation, rests upon a value judgement about how much confidence is needed to support a hypothesis, which may vary depending on the hypothesis (Rudner 1953.) Data do not interpret themselves; that requires, for better or worse, human judgment.

Far from replacing philosophy, then, the process of interpreting science may in fact be an act of philosophizing. Seen this way, the aims of philosophy and of science may often be continuous, and the numerous partnerships between scientists and philosophers make sense. Physicists work alongside philosophers of physics because understanding sometimes requires expertise cultivated in different fields (Callender 2011).

Sciences can also be freighted with ideas, ideologies, and associations that are sometimes difficult to recognize. Science often appears as a straightforward endeavor categorically distinct from all others, yet this may be a mistake: “Scientific practices are often construed as apart from any surrounding culture, and even free from culture, but such construals are not adequate to the richness and complexity of scientific work. Recognizing the intimate entanglement of the sciences with other practices does not diminish or blur their significance but instead acknowledges their pervasiveness throughout the world” (Rouse 2002, 166).

Further, many scientific procedures are interwoven with mathematics, and yet it is hardly obvious that math could share the same status, alongside science, as empirical knowledge because it seems that the objects of mathematical understanding are abstract entities. If science is intertwined with mathematics and a host of other cultural ideas and practices that may make it harder to neatly distinguish science and valorize it over and above other claims to knowledge.

e. Science as Conditional, Not Absolute, Good

A separate line of critique focuses especially on Scientism 4 above, namely that scientific knowledge is an obvious, or overriding or intrinsic good. Philosophers as distinct as Nietzsche, James, and Feyerabend have argued against this picture, supposing instead that the goods of scientific knowledge are subordinate to some higher good, for example human flourishing. They take it that scientific knowledge may be a component of such flourishing but does not itself constitute flourishing. They also note that nothing in the sciences themselves furnishes the answer to why they are supposedly an intrinsic good.

f. Wittgensteinian Critique

Not everyone associated with the Vienna Circle (discussed above in 2d) advocated scientistic philosophies. Ludwig Wittgenstein, who helped place logic front and center for logical positivism, did seek to diagnose and dismiss some philosophical problems as pseudo-problems, or mere entrapments of language. But unlike some other logical positivists, he did not want to eliminate metaphysics altogether but arguably to protect metaphysics from inappropriate scientific analyses. If the tools of science could not appropriately analyze God, logic, free will, or beauty, that did not make them “nonsense” but simply beyond the scope of science. Wittgenstein’s metaphysics were ineffable but not eliminated. Metaphysics was preserved as real (if mystical) and thereby defended from spurious attempts to render intelligible what is not intelligible. A common interpretation of Wittgenstein’s work is that it was a bulwark against scientism (Monk 2005, Beale and Kidd 2017).

g. Education, Chauvinism, and Philistinism

Proponents of scientism might reasonably emphasize the importance of science teaching: if science is the best or only source of knowledge, then it seems natural that educations should prioritize its instruction. But it may be problematic to do so at the expense of non-scientific topics. There may be good reasons to believe humanities are central to good educations and should be protected and encouraged. Topics such as history, philosophy, literature, and music may be intrinsically valuable or they may advance any number of other goals, such as spiritual flourishing, moral development, critical thought, and the cultivation of democratic political sentiment (Nussbaum 2012, Grimm et al. 2025). The derogation of the humanities would be an unfortunate result of scientism, especially given a current climate in which liberal educations are consistently threatened with austerity, privatization, and narrowly economic utilitarian standards.

While some well-known debates have pitted champions of science against champions of the humanities (for example, the Huxley-Arnold exchange of the 1880s, or the Snow-Leavis “Two Cultures” debate of the 1960s) very rarely have any such partisans argued for the exclusive teaching of just humanities or sciences. Most all have agreed that there is value in educations including both natural inquiry and humanities – as has been standard in university curricula since their medieval origins with the seven liberal (freeing) arts. James even claimed it would be a mistake to divorce sciences from humanities, since any topic would be humanistic insofar as it is taught historically (1911).

Yet some varieties of scientism could promote an anti-intellectual philistinism, an indifference to the arts or to broader engagement with culture. Because the scientistic sentiment demotes non-scientific claims, its proponents might know less about the arguments of historians, philosophers, theologians, or poets who also make claims about reality. This could result in a vicious cycle of reenforcing prejudice: if non-scientific subjects are deemed less valuable at the outset, then one might safely devote less time to their study, only to conclude there is not much worth knowing. But this would be an unfortunate intellectual chauvinism.

h. Non-scientific Political Values

Scientism can have serious social consequences: if a group becomes convinced that a particular set of policies must be adopted on scientific grounds, they might be blinded to the extra-scientific considerations still relevant to that policy – considerations that are fundamentally political in nature. While any society that believes science is worth doing naturally expects to use it in some way, decisions about implementation are rarely straightforward. Top-down attempts to reconfigure society along supposedly scientific principles have often proved illiberal and harmful. Untold horrors were committed in the name of purportedly scientific dictates of Marxist politics. Eugenics enjoyed startlingly broad support through the first half of the 20^th century from a diversity of backers who were generally convinced of its scientific merits. The point is not just that we can be wrong about the epistemic status of movements like communism or eugenics, but that the will to implement them because of their claims to scientific authority might overlook other legitimate and robustly political concerns about, say, justice or tradition.

i. Non-scientific Forms of Inquiry

Perhaps science is only one among several kinds of knowledge, and the realm of truth is not limited to scientific truths. Arguably there could be many others; here we will consider three. Hayek warned against the scientistic mistake of assuming we can study social systems in the way we study solar systems: the inherent complexities of humans and human institutions limit scientific analyses. For Hayek, social knowledge was possible but it was not “scientific” in the same sense as chemical knowledge because it draws essentially on first-person introspective understanding about human motivation (1937). Secondly, some philosophers have argued for the autonomy of their discipline based on its distinctive and legitimate reliance on intuitions, which, while fallible, have sufficiently strong connections to the truth (Bealer 1996). Historical knowledge may likewise be a non-scientific type of knowing. Philosophers Wilhelm Dilthey, R.G. Collingwood, and Michael Oakeshott each formulated views about historical understanding to the effect that it was a legitimate type of systematic knowledge but was nevertheless conceptually separate from science. Broadly speaking, these thinkers drew upon a distinction between the realms of natural necessity and human freedom, supposing that agential human affairs require a type of interpretation that rocks and quasars do not (see also Kitcher 2017).

j. Intellectual Virtue and Vice

Many articulations of scientism have elicited morally charged critiques involving accusations of arrogance or dogmatism. At least one analysis develops these critiques within the framework of virtue epistemology, which involves identifying virtuous habits of mind that promote intellectual flourishing, or vicious habits of mind that conversely make someone a less excellent thinker. It is possible that those adopting scientistic stances may fall prey to the vice of close-mindedness insofar as they are less likely to intellectually engage with thinkers from other disciplines or traditions, or insofar as they are closed to the possibility of sources of inquiry that are not scientific (Kidd 2017).

5. References and Further Reading

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Cartwright, Nancy. 1999. The Dappled World: A Study of the Boundaries of Science. Cambridge University Press.
Cartwright, Nancy et al. 2008. Otto Neurath: Philosophy between Science and Politics. Cambridge University Press.
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Author Information

Eric Martin
Email: Eric_Marton@baylor.edu
Baylor University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy