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Mind and Multiple Realizability

The claim that mental types are multiply realizable has played an important role in supporting antireductionism in philosophy of mind. The multiple-realizability thesis implies that mental types and physical types are correlated one-many not one-one. A mental state such as pain might be correlated with one type of physical state in a human and another type of physical state in, say, a Martian or pain-capable robot. This has often been taken to imply that mental types are not identical to physical types since their identity would require one type of mental state to be correlated with only one type of physical state. The principal debate about multiple realizability in philosophy of mind concerns its compatibility or incompatibility with reductionism. On the assumption that reduction requires mental-physical type identities, the apparent multiple realizability of mental types, such as a pain being both a type of human brain state and a type of robot state, has been understood to support antireductionism. More recent work has challenged this understanding.

The antireductionist argument depends on the following premises:

  1. Mental types are multiply realizable;
  2. If mental types are multiply realizable, then they are not identical to physical types;
  3. If mental types are not identical to physical types, then psychological discourse (vernacular or scientific) is not reducible to physical theory.

Among these claims, the most controversial has been Premise 1, the multiple-realizability thesis. Antireductionists have supported it both a priori by appeal to conceivability-possibility principles, and a posteriori by appeal to findings in biology, neuroscience, and artificial intelligence research. Reductionists have criticized these arguments, and they have also directly challenged the antireductionist premises.

Reductionist challenges to Premises 1 and 2 claim that antireductionists dubiously assume that psychophysical relations must be reckoned relative to our current mental and physical typologies. Contrary to this assumption, some reductionists argue that future scientific investigation will result in the formulation of new mental and/or physical typologies which fail to support the antireductionist premises. Typology-based arguments of this sort have been among the most important and most widely discussed reductionist responses to the multiple-realizability argument. Responses that target Premise 3 have been less popular. They argue either that psychophysical reduction can be carried out without identity statements linking mental and physical types, or else that ontological issues concerning the identity or nonidentity of mental and physical types are completely orthogonal to the issue of reduction.

The multiple-realizability thesis has also played an important role in recent discussions about nonreductive physicalism. The antireductionist argument has often been taken to recommend some type of nonreductive physicalism. Recently, however, Jaegwon Kim has effectively stood the argument on its head. He argues that physicalists who endorse multiple realizability are committed either to denying that mental types are genuine properties, ones that make a causal difference to their bearers, or else they are committed to endorsing some type of reductionism which identifies mental types with physical types.

Table of Contents

  1. Multiple Realizability and the Antireductionist Argument
    1. Multiple Realizability and Multiple Correlatability
    2. Identity Theory, Functionalism and the Realization Relation
    3. Defining Multiple Realizability
    4. Multiple Realizability and Mental-Physical Type Identities
    5. Type Identities and Psychophysical Reductionism
  2. Arguments for the Multiple-Realizability Thesis
    1. Conceptual Arguments for the MRT
    2. Empirical Arguments for the MRT
  3. Responses to the Antireductionist Argument
    1. Typology-Based Responses
      1. New Mental Typologies: The Local Reduction Move
      2. New Physical Typologies I
      3. New Physical Typologies II: The Disjunctive Move
        1. Law-Based Criticisms
        2. Metaphysical Criticisms
      4. Coordinate Typologies
    2. Reduction-Based Responses
  4. Multiple Realizability and Nonreductive Physicalism
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Multiple Realizability and the Antireductionist Argument

Multiple-realizability theses claim that it is possible for the tokens of a certain type to be realized by tokens of two or more distinct types. Multiple-realizability theses can be applied to a broad range of types: chemical, biological, social, mathematical. But what has been of primary interest in philosophy of mind is the purported multiple realizability of mental types. In what follows, the multiple-realizability thesis (MRT) will be understood as the claim that specifically mental types are multiply realizable.

Roughly, a type φ is multiply realizable if and only if it is possible for φ-tokens to be realized by tokens of two or more distinct types. If, for instance, it is possible for tokens of the mental type pain to be realized by tokens of the types c-fiber firing and q-fiber firing, where c-fiber firingq-fiber firing, then pain is a multiply-realizable mental type. Debate about the MRT in philosophy of mind has principally concerned its compatibility or incompatibility with reductionism. The MRT has been widely understood to have antireductionist implications. It seems to imply that mental types are not identical to physical types. If psychophysical reduction requires mental-physical type identities, then the MRT seems to imply that psychophysical reductionism is false.

The antireductionist argument is roughly as follows: Suppose a certain type of mental state – pain, say – is multiply realizable. We discover, for instance, that Alexander’s pains are intimately correlated in a way we label ‘realization’ with a certain type of physical occurrence, the firing of his c-fibers. We also discover, however, that Madeleine’s pains are realized not by c-fiber firing but by a distinct type of physical occurrence, q-fiber firing. Since c-fiber firing does not in any way involve q-fiber firing, and q-fiber firing does not in any way involve c-fiber firing, we conclude that pain can occur without c-fiber firing, and that it can also occur without q-fiber firing. We conclude, in other words, that neither c-fiber firing nor q-fiber firing is by itself necessary for the occurrence of pain. In that case, however, it seems that pain cannot be identical to either type of physical occurrence since identity implies necessary coextension. If having a mass of 1 kilogram is identical to having a mass of 2.2 pounds, then necessarily something has a mass of 1 kilogram if and only if it has a mass of 2.2 pounds. Likewise, if pain is identical to c-fiber firing, then necessarily anything that has pain will also have c-fiber firing; and if pain is identical to q-fiber firing, then necessarily anything that has pain will also have q-fiber firing. Madeleine, however, experiences pain without c-fiber firing, and Alexander experiences pain without q-fiber firing. Since pain is not correlated with a single physical type, it seems that pain cannot be identical to a physical type. Moreover, because the identity of type M and type P implies that necessarily every M-token is a P-token, we need not actually discover the correlation of pain with diverse physical types; the bare possibility of such correlations is sufficient for the argument to succeed. If the case of Alexander and Madeleine is even possible, it would follow that pain is not a physical type; and, says the argument, it seems intuitively certain or at least overwhelmingly probable that this type of situation is possible not only for pain, but for all mental types. Since psychophysical reductionism requires that mental types be identical to physical types, psychophysical reductionism must be false.

The foregoing line of reasoning has been extremely influential since 1970. It is largely responsible for what has been and continues to be a widespread, decades-long consensus that psychophysical reductionism must be false. The argument trades on the following premises:

  1. Mental types are multiply realizable;
  2. If mental types are multiply realizable, then they are not identical to physical types;
  3. If mental types are not identical to physical types, then psychological discourse (vernacular or scientific) is not reducible to physical theory.

These premises will be considered in order.

a. Multiple Realizability and Multiple Correlatability

The term ‘multiple realizability’ is often used as a label for any claim to the effect that mental and physical types are correlated one-many. Properly speaking, however, multiple realizability is tied to the notion of realization. Since the notion of realization is tied to a particular account of mental properties and psychological language it will be helpful to distinguish the multiple-realizability thesis from a more general multiple-correlatability thesis (MCT), a claim to the effect that φ-tokens might be correlated with tokens of more than one type.

The form of a bare multiple-correlatability argument against psychophysical identification is something like the following:

1. If mental type M = physical type P, then necessarily every M-token is a P-token and vice versa;

2. It is not necessarily the case that every M-token is a P-token and vice versa;

Therefore, mental type M ≠ physical type P.

Given reasonable assumptions the first premise follows from Leibniz’s law: type-identity implies necessary token coextension. Premise 2 states the MCT: M-tokens and P-tokens needn’t be correlated one-one. An MCT does not specify whether M- and P-tokens are systematically related to each other or in what way. It is thus weaker than the MRT which claims specifically that tokens of one type realize tokens of the other type.

One important observation here is that the MRT is not the only way of endorsing an MCT. Bealer (1994), for instance, defends an MCT in a way that does not appeal to realization at all. Moreover, even Putnam, who is often credited with having been the first to advance a multiple-realizability argument against psychophysical identity theory, appealed to a bare MCT as opposed to an MRT:

Consider what the brain-state theorist has to do to make good his claims. He has to specify a physical-chemical state such that any organism… is in pain if and only if (a) it possesses a brain of a suitable physical-chemical structure; and (b) its brain is in that physical-chemical state. This means that the physical-chemical state in question must be a possible state of a mammalian brain, a reptilian brain, a mollusc’s brain… etc. At the same time, it must not be a possible… state of the brain of any physical possible creature that cannot feel pain… [I]t is not altogether impossible that such a state will be found… [I]t is at least possible that parallel evolution, all over the universe, might always lead to one and the same physical “correlate” of pain. But this is certainly an ambitious hypothesis (Putnam 1967a: 436).

Putnam claims it is highly unlikely that pain is correlated with exactly one physico-chemical state. There is no mention of realization.

The notion of realization was introduced in connection with functionalism, the theory Putnam advanced as an alternative to the identity theory. According to functionalism mental types are not identical to physical types; they are instead realized by physical types. Putnam argued that functionalism was more plausible than the identity theory precisely because it was compatible with mental types being correlated one-many with physical types. Before discussing this point, however, it will be helpful to say a word about functionalism since the term ‘functionalism’ has been used to refer to theories of at least two different types: a type originally inspired by a computational model of psychological discourse and developed in a series of papers by Putnam (1960, 1964, 1967a, 1967b); and a type of identity theory endorsed by Lewis (1966, 1970, 1972, 1980) and independently by Armstrong (1968, 1970). Talk of realization has been used in connection with both.

b. Identity Theory, Functionalism and the Realization Relation

Early identity theorists claimed that psychological discourse was like theoretical discourse in the natural sciences. Mental states, they said, were entities postulated by a theory to explain the behavior of persons in something analogous to the way atoms, forces, and the like were entities postulated by a theory to explain motion and change generally (Sellars 1956: 181-87; 1962: 33-34; Putnam 1963: 330-331, 363; Feigl 1958: 440ff.; Fodor 1968a: 93; Churchland 1989: 2-6). The entities postulated by psychological discourse – beliefs, desires, pains, hopes, fears – were to be identified on the basis of empirical evidence with entities postulated by the natural sciences, most likely entities postulated by neuroscience. Originally, identity theorists supposed that theoretical identifications of this sort were a matter of choice. Empirical data would support correlations between mental and physical types such as ‘Whenever there is pain, there is c-fiber firing’, and scientists would then choose to identify the correlated types on grounds of parsimony. Identifying pain with c-fiber firing would yield a more elegant theory than merely correlating the two, and it would avoid the potentially embarrassing task of having to explain why pain and c-fiber firing would be correlated one-one if they were in fact distinct (Smart 1962). Lewis (1966) criticized this model of theoretical identification, and advanced an alternative which was also endorsed independently by Armstrong (1968, 1970).

According to the Lewis-Armstrong alternative, theoretical identifications are not chosen on grounds of parsimony, but are actually implied by the logic of scientific investigation. In our ordinary, pre-scientific dealings we often introduce terms to refer to things which we identify on the basis of their typical environmental causes and typical behavioral effects. We introduce the term ‘pain’, for instance, to refer to the type of occurrence, whatever it happens to be, that is typically caused by pinpricks, burns, and abrasions, and that typically causes winces, groans, screams, and similar behavior. That type of occurrence then becomes a target for further scientific investigation which aims to discover what it is in fact. Pain is thus identified by definition with the type of occurrence that has such-and-such typical causes and effects, and that type of occurrence is then identified by scientific investigation with c-fiber firing. Pain is thus identified with c-fiber firing by the transitivity of identity. Call this sort of view the Lewis-Armstrong identity theory.

By contrast with the Lewis-Armstrong identity theory, functionalism claims that psychological states are postulates of abstract descriptions which deploy categories analogous to those used in computer science or information-theoretic models of cognitive functioning. Functionalists agree with identity theorists that psychological discourse constitutes a theory, but they disagree about what type of theory it is. Psychological discourse is not like a natural scientific theory, functionalists claim, but like an abstract one. The mental states it postulates are analogous to, say, the angles and lines postulated by Euclidean geometry. We arrive at Euclidean principles by abstraction, a process in which we focus on a narrow range of properties and then construct “idealized” descriptions of them. We focus, for instance, on the spatial properties of the objects around us. We ignore what they are made of, what colors they have, how much they weigh, and the like, and focus simply on their dimensions. We then idealize our descriptions of them: slightly crooked lines, for instance, we describe as straight; deviant curves we describe as normal, and so on. According to functionalists, something analogous is true of psychological discourse. It provides abstract descriptions of real-world systems, descriptions which ignore the physical details of those systems (the sorts of details described by the natural sciences), and focus simply on a narrow profile of their features. Originally Putnam suggested that those features were analogous to the features postulated by Turing machines.

A Turing machine is an abstract description which postulates a set of states related to each other and to various inputs and outputs in certain determinate ways described by a machine table. A certain machine table might postulate states, S1,…,Sn, inputs, I1,…, Im, and outputs O1,…,Op, for instance, which are related in ways expressed by a set of statements or instructions such as the following:

If the system is in state S13 and receives input I7, then the system will produce output O32, and enter state S3.

According to Putnam’s original proposal, which has come to be called machine functionalism, psychological descriptions are abstract descriptions of this sort. They postulate relations among sensory inputs, motor outputs, and internal mental states. The only significant difference between Turing machine descriptions and psychological descriptions, Putnam (1967a) suggested, was that psychological inputs, outputs, and internal states were related to each other probabilistically not deterministically. If, for instance, Eleanor believes there are exactly eight planets in our solar system, and she receives the auditory input, “Do you believe there are exactly eight planets in our solar system,” then she will produce the verbal output, “Yes,” not with a deterministic probability of 1, but with a probability between 1 and 0.

Functionalists need not endorse a Turing machine model of psychological discourse; they could instead understand psychological discourse by appeal to models in, say, cognitive psychology; but in general, they make two claims. First, psychological discourse is abstract discourse which postulates an inventory of objects, properties, states or the like which are related to each other in ways expressed by the theory’s principles. Second, the behavior of certain concrete systems maps onto the objects, properties, or states that psychological discourse postulates. The notion of realization concerns this second claim.

Let T be a theory describing various relations among its postulates, S1,…,Sn.The relations among the concrete states of a certain concrete system might be in some way isomorphic to the relations among S1,…,Sn. If T says that state S1 results in state S2 with a probability of .73 given state S15, it might turn out that, for instance, Alexander’s brain state B5 results in brain state B67 with a probability of .73 given neural stimulus B4. It might turn out, in other words, that states B5, B67, and B4 in Alexander’s brain provide a model of the relations among S1, S2, and S15 in T. If this were true for all of Alexander’s brain states, one might say that T described a certain type of functional organization, an organization which was realized by Alexander’s brain, and one might call Alexander’s brain a realization of T. The states of Alexander’s brain are related to each other in ways that are isomorphic with the ways in which S1,…,Sn, are related according to T. In fact, concrete systems in general might be said to realize the states postulated by abstract descriptions. The wooden table realizes a Euclidean rectangle; the movements of electrons through the silicon circuitry of a pocket calculator realize a certain algorithm; the movements of ions through the neural circuitry of Alexander’s brain realize a belief that 2 + 2 = 4, and so forth.

Realization, then, is a relation between certain types of abstract descriptions, on the one hand, and concrete systems whose states are in a relevant sense isomorphic with those postulated by abstract descriptions, on the other. Philosophers of mind have offered several different accounts of this relation. Putnam (1970: 313-315) suggested a type of account which has proved very influential. Realization, he said, can be understood as a relation between higher-order and lower-order types (he used the term ‘properties’) or tokens of such types. Higher-order types are ones whose definitions quantify over other types. Second-order types, for instance, are types whose definitions quantify over first-order types, and first-order types are types whose definitions quantify over no types. Effectively what Putnam suggested is that having mental states amounted to having some set of (first-order) internal states related to each other in ways that collectively satisfied a certain functional description. Being in pain, for instance, might be defined as being in some concrete first-order state S1 which results in a concrete first-order state S2 with a probability of .73 given a concrete state S15. In other words, the various Si postulated by theory T can be understood as variables ranging over concrete first-order state types such as brain state types. To say, then, that Alexander’s brain is currently realizing a state of pain is just to say that the triple < B5, B67, B4 > of concrete first-order states of his brain satisfies the definition of being in pain, a definition which quantifies over concrete first-order states of some sort.

The concept of realization is understood slightly differently in connection with the Lewis-Armstrong identity theory. That difference reflects the more general difference between the identity theory and functionalism. Functionalism takes mental states to be states postulated by an abstract description, whereas the Lewis-Armstrong identity theory takes mental states to be concrete physical states which have been described in terms of an abstract vocabulary. To help illustrate this difference consider a very rough analogy with a Platonic versus Aristotelian understanding of geometrical objects. The Platonist claims that ‘rectangle’ refers to an abstract object postulated and/or described by Euclidean geometry. The Aristotelian, by contrast, claims that ‘rectangle’ is a way of referring to various concrete objects in terms of their dimensions. There is a roughly analogous sense in which the functionalist claims that ‘pain’ expresses a type of abstract state whereas the Lewis-Armstrong identity theorist claims that ‘pain’ expresses a concrete type of physical state such as c-fiber firing. According to the identity theorist ‘pain’ refers to a physical state by appeal to a narrow profile of that state’s properties such as its typical causes and effects. According to the Lewis-Armstrong identity theory, then, what a theory such as T provides is not an inventory of abstract states, but an apparatus for referring to certain physical ones. On the Lewis-Armstrong theory those physical states, the ones expressed by the predicates and terms of T, provide a realization of T.

Because the multiple-realizability argument for antireductionism principally concerns the functionalist notion of realization, the term ‘realize’ and its cognates should be taken to express that notion in what follows.

c. Defining Multiple Realizability

Let us consider again the rough definition of multiple realizability stated earlier: a type φ is multiply realizable if and only if it is possible for φ-tokens to be realized by tokens of two or more distinct types. To make this more precise it will be helpful to draw some distinctions.

First, Shoemaker (1981) distinguishes what he calls a state’s core realizer from what he calls its total realizer. Consider again the theory T and Alexander’s brain. If B5 is the type of brain state which corresponds to S1 in T, then B5-tokens are core realizers of S1-tokens in Alexander’s brain. The total realizer of an S1-token, on the other hand, includes tokens of B5 together with tokens of the other types of states in Alexander’s brain whose relations to one another are collectively isomorphic with the relations among S1,…,Sn, expressed in T. The MRT has typically been understood to be a claim about core realizers.

Second, it is helpful to clarify ambiguities in the scope of the modal operator. The foregoing definition of multiple realizability is unclear, for instance, about whether or not -tokens must be realized by tokens of more than one type in the same world, or whether it is sufficient that -tokens be realized by tokens of more than one type in different worlds. Similarly, it is unclear about which worlds are relevant: nomologically possible worlds? metaphysically possible worlds? The following definition clears up these ambiguities:

[Def] A type M is multiply realizable iffdf. (i) possiblyM, P-tokens are core realizers of M-tokens, and (ii) possiblyM, Q-tokens are core realizers of M-tokens, and (iii) PQ.

Here, ‘possiblyM’ designates metaphysical possibility. (The subscript ‘M’ will be used henceforth to indicate that a modal operator covers metaphysically possible worlds.) Metaphysical possibility is all that is needed for the multiple-realizability argument to proceed. If M were identical to P, then it would not be possible for M-tokens to exist without P-tokens (or vice versa) in any possible world irrespective of other factors such the laws of nature obtaining at those worlds.

Consider again the original example concerning pain. According to the foregoing definition of multiple realizability, pain is multiply realizable if and only if there is a metaphysically possible world in which tokens of, say, c-fiber firing are core realizers of pain-tokens, and there is a metaphysically possible world in which tokens of a different type – say, q-fiber firing – are core realizers of pain-tokens. Hence, if token c-fiber firings are core realizers of Alexander’s pain-tokens in world w1, and token q-fiber firings are core realizers of Madeleine’s pain-tokens in world w2, then pain is a multiply-realizable mental type. Moreover, if w1 and w2 are identical with the actual world, then we can say not only that pain is multiply realizable, but that pain is also multiply realized.

d. Multiple Realizability and Mental-Physical Type Identities

As mentioned earlier, the MRT is one way of endorsing an MCT. The second premise of the antireductionist argument reflects this idea. It claims that if mental types are multiply realizable, then they are not identical to physical types. The argument for this premise trades on the following claim:

P1. Necessarily, for mental type M and physical type P, if M is multiply realizable, then it is not necessarilyM the case every M-token is a P-token and vice versa.

The antecedent of this conditional expresses the MRT, and the consequent expresses an MCT.

Claim P1 is supported by an additional assumption: mental types are not necessarilyMcorealized. If, for instance, a Q-token realizes an M-token, then the M-token needn’t be realized by some other token in addition. Hence, to show that M-tokens and P-tokens needn’t be correlated one-one it is sufficient to show that it is possible to have an M-token without having a P-token. Suppose, then, that in world w there is a Q-token that realizes an M-token. In order for it to follow from this that M-tokens couldM occur without P-tokens, we need to assume that, say, a Q-token doesn’t itself require a P-token – that a Q-token could realize an M-token on its own. We might call this assumption Corealizer Contingency: mental types don’t needM to be co-realized. Corealizer Contingency implies that it is possibleM for an M-token to be realized by, say, a Q-token alone, and hence it is possibleM that there might be an M-token without there being a P-token. The conclusion that M is not identical to P if M is multiply realizable now follows from the following premise:

P2. If type M = type P, then necessarilyM every M-token is a P-token and vice versa.

According to P2 the identity of M- and P-types requires the necessaryM coextension of M- and P-tokens. By the foregoing argument, however, if M is multiply realizable it is not necessarilyM the case that there is an M-token if and only if there is a P-token. Hence, it follows that if M is multiply realizable, it is not identical to P.

Now for some terminology. For types φ and ψ, call φ one of ψ’s realizing types just in case possiblyM a φ-token realizes a ψ-token. In that case, one can say that the argument based on P1 and P2 purports to show that if M is multiply realizable, M is not identical to any of its realizing types.

e. Type Identities and Psychophysical Reductionism

Psychophysical reductionism claims that psychological discourse is reducible to some type of natural scientific theory such as a neuroscientific one. Paradigmatically, intertheoretic reduction reflects a certain type of ontological and epistemological situation. Domain A is included within Domain B, but for reasons concerning the way people are outfitted epistemically, they have come to know A-entities in a way different from the way they have come to know other B-entities. They have therefore come to describe and explain the behavior of A-entities using a theoretical framework, TA, which is different from the theoretical framework they have used to describe and explain the behavior of other B-entities, the framework TB. The result is that they do not initially recognize the inclusion of Domain A in Domain B. People later discover, however, that Domain A is really part of Domain B; A-entities really just are B-entities of a certain sort, and hence the behavior of A-entities can be exhaustively described and explained in B-theoretic terms. This situation is reflected in a certain relationship between TA and TB. The principles governing the behavior of A-entities, the principles expressed by the law statements of TA, are just special applications of the principles governing the behavior of B-entities in general – the principles expressed by the law statements of TB. The laws of TA, they say, are reducible to the laws of TB; and they say that they are able to provide a reductive description and explanation of A-behavior in B-theoretic terms. A-statements can be derived from B-statements given certain assumptions about the conditions that distinguish A-entities from B-entities of other sorts – so-called boundary conditions. The descriptive and explanatory roles played by the law statements of TA, the reduced theory, are thus taken over by the law statements of the more inclusive reducing theory, TB.

Consider an example. Kepler’s laws are thought to have been reduced to Newton’s. Newton’s laws imply that massive bodies will behave in certain ways given the application of certain forces. If those laws are applied to planetary bodies in particular – if, in other words, people examine the implications of those laws within the boundaries of our planetary system – the laws predict that those bodies will behave in roughly the way Kepler’s laws describe. Kepler’s laws, the laws of the reduced theory, are therefore shown to be special applications of Newton’s laws, the laws of the reducing theory. To the extent that they are accurate, Kepler’s laws really just express the application of Newton’s laws to planetary bodies. One upshot of this circumstance is that people can appeal to Newton’s laws to explain why Kepler’s laws obtain: they obtain because Newtonian laws imply that a system operating within the parameters of our planetary system will behave in roughly the way Kepler’s laws describe.

Intertheoretic reduction is thus marked by the inclusion of one domain in another, and by the explanation of the laws governing the included domain by the laws governing the inclusive one. There have been many attempts to give a precise formulation of the idea of intertheoretic reduction. Those attempts trade on certain assumptions about the nature of theories and the nature of explanation. One of the earliest and most influential attempts was Ernest Nagel’s (1961). Nagel endorsed a syntactic model of theories and a covering-law model of explanation. Roughly, the syntactic model of theories claimed that theories were sets of law statements, and the covering-law model of explanation claimed that explanation was deduction from law statements (Hempel 1965). According to Nagel’s model of reduction, to say that TA was reducible to TB was to say that the law statements of TA were deducible from the law statements of TB in conjunction with statements describing various boundary conditions and bridge principles if necessary. Bridge principles are empirically-supported premises which connect the vocabularies of theories which do not share the same stock of predicates and terms. On the Nagel model of reduction, bridge principles are necessary for intertheoretic reduction if the reduced theory’s vocabulary has predicates and terms which the vocabulary of the reducing theory lacks. Suppose, for instance, that LA is a law statement of TA which is slated for deduction from LB, a law statement of TB:

LA For any x, if A1(x), then A2(x);
LB For any x, if B1(x), then B2(x).

Since the vocabulary of TB does not include the predicates A1 or A2, additional premises such as the following are required for the deduction:

ID1 A1 = B1
ID2 A2 = B2;

Given ID1 and ID2, LA can be derived from LB by the substitution of equivalent expressions.

The reduction of thermodynamics to statistical mechanics is often cited as an example of reduction via bridge principles. The term ‘heat’, which occurs in the law statements of thermodynamics, is not included in the vocabulary of statistical mechanics. As a result, the deduction of thermodynamic law statements from mechanical ones requires the use of additional premises connecting the theories’ respective vocabularies. An example might be the following:

Heat = mean molecular kinetic energy.

Identity statements of this sort are called theoretical identifications. The theoretical identification of X with Y is supposed to be marked by two features. First, the identity is supposed to be discovered empirically. By analogy, members of a certain linguistic community might use the name ‘Hesperus’ to refer to a star that appears in the West in early evening, and they might use the name ‘Phosphorus’ to refer to a star that appears in the East in early morning, and yet they might not know but later discover that those names refer to the same star. Second, however, unlike the Hesperus–Phosphorus case, in the case of theoretical identifications, at least one of the predicates or terms, ‘X’ or ‘Y’, is supposed to belong to a theory.

There are numerous episodes of theoretical identification in the history of science, cases in which we developed descriptive and explanatory frameworks with different vocabularies the predicates and terms of which we later discovered to refer to or express the very same things. The terms ‘light’ and ‘electromagnetic radiation with wavelengths of 380 – 750nm’, for instance, originally belonged to distinct forms of discourse: one to electromagnetic theory, the other to a prescientific way of describing things. Those terms were nevertheless discovered to refer to the very same phenomenon. In the Nagel model of reduction, theoretical identifications operate as bridge principles linking the vocabulary of the reduced theory with vocabulary of the reducing theory. They therefore underwrite the possibility of intertheoretic reduction.

The Nagel model of reduction has been extensively criticized, and alternative models of reduction have been based on different assumptions about the nature of theories and explanation. But the idea that reduction involves the inclusion of one domain in another implies that the entities postulated by the reduced theory be identical to entities postulated by the reducing theory. In claiming to have reduced Kepler’s laws to Newton’s, for instance, the assumption is that planets are massive bodies, not merely objects the behaviors of which are correlated with the behaviors of massive bodies.

To illustrate the necessity of identity for reduction, imagine that Domains A and B comprise completely distinct entities whose behaviors are nevertheless correlated with each other. It turns out, for instance, that the principles governing the instantiation of A-types and those governing the instantiation of B-types are isomorphic in the following sense: for every A-law there is a corresponding B-law, and vice versa; and in addition, tokens of A-types are correlated one-one with tokens of B-types. Given this isomorphism, biconditionals such as the following end up being true:

BC1 Necessarily, for any x, A1(x) if and only if B1(x);
BC2 Necessarily, for any x, A2(x) if and only if B2(x).

Such biconditionals could underwrite the deduction of law statements such as LA from law statements such as LB. What they could not underwrite, however, is the claim that TA is reducible to TB. The reason is that A and B are completely distinct domains which merely happen to be correlated. This is not a case in which one domain is discovered to be part of another, more inclusive domain, and hence it is not a case in which the laws of one domain can be explained by appeal to the laws of another. Without identity statements such as ID1 and ID2, there is no inclusion of one domain in another, and without that sort of inclusion, there is no explanation of the reduced theory’s laws in terms of the reducing theory’s laws. (See Causey 1977: Chapter 4; Schaffner 1967; Hooker 1981: Part III.)

Sklar (1967) argued that reduction requires bridge principles taking the form of identity statements by appeal to an example: the Wiedemann-Franz law. The Wiedemann-Franz law expresses a correlation between thermal conductivity and electrical conductivity in metals. It allows for the deduction of law statements about the latter from law statements about the former. This deducibility, however, has never been understood to warrant the claim that the theory of electrical conductivity is reducible to the theory of heat conductivity, or vice versa. Rather, it points in the direction of a different reduction, the reduction of the macroscopic theory of matter to the microscopic theory of matter.

Suppose, then, that we apply the foregoing account of reduction to psychological discourse. Since that account claims that theoretical identifications are necessary for intertheoretic reduction, the upshot is that psychophysical reduction requires mental-physical type identities. The reduction of psychological discourse to some branch of natural science would require that mental entities be identified with entities postulated by the relevant branch of natural science. It could not involve two distinct yet coordinate domains. This is clear if we imagine a case involving psychophysical parallelism. Suppose two completely distinct ontological domains, one comprising bodies, the other nonphysical Cartesian egos, were governed by principles that happened to be isomorphic in the sense just described: the laws governing the behavior of bodies parallel the laws governing the behavior of the Cartesian egos, and the states of the Cartesian egos are distinct from but nevertheless correlated one-one with certain bodily states. In that case, it would be possible to make deductions about the behavior of Cartesian egos on the basis of the behavior of bodies, but this deducibility would not warrant the claim that the behavior of Cartesian egos was reducible to the behavior of bodies. The behavior of bodies might provide a helpful model or heuristic for understanding or predicting the behavior of Cartesian egos, but it would not provide a reducing theory which explained why the laws governing Cartesian egos obtained. The same point would follow if some type of neutral monism were true – if, say, mental and physical phenomena were correlated, but were both reducible to some third conceptual framework which was neither mental nor physical but neutral. Mere correlations between mental and physical types, even ones which are lawlike, are not sufficient to underwrite psychophysical reduction. Psychophysical reductionism requires the identity of mental and physical types.

Consider now the putative implications of this claim in conjunction with the MRT. Psychophysical reduction requires psychophysical type identities. If mental types are multiply realizable, then they are not identical to any of their physical realizing types. But if mental types are not identical to physical types (the tacit assumption being that the only physical candidates for identification with mental types are their realizing types), then psychological discourse is not reducible to physical theory.

2. Arguments for the Multiple-Realizability Thesis

Section 1 discussed the connection between multiple realizability and antireductionism. Antireductionists argue that if mental types are multiply realizable, then psychophysical reductionism is false. But why suppose that mental types are multiply realizable? Why suppose the MRT is true? The MRT has been supported in at least two ways: by appeal to conceptual or intuitive considerations, and by appeal to empirical findings in biology, neuroscience, and artificial intelligence research. In this section, arguments of both types will be considered.

a. Conceptual Arguments for the MRT

Conceivability arguments for the MRT claim that conceivability or intuition is a reliable guide to possibility. If that is the case, and it is conceivable that mental types might be correlated one-many with physical types, then it is possible that mental types might be correlated one-many with physical types. And, say exponents of the argument, one-many psychophysical correlations are surely conceivable. Consider the broad range of perfectly intelligible scenarios science fiction writers are able to imagine – scenarios in which robots and extraterrestrials with physiologies very different from ours are able to experience pain, belief, desire, and other mental states without the benefit of c-fibers, cerebral hemispheres, or other any of the other physical components that are correlated with mental states in humans. If these scenarios are conceivable and conceivability is a more or less reliable guide to possibility, then we can conclude that these scenarios really are possible. Conceivability arguments for the MRT, then, trade on the following premises:

CA1 If it is conceivable that mental types are multiply realizable, then mental types are multiply realizable;

CA2 It is conceivable that mental types are multiply realizable.

Therefore, mental types are multiply realizable.

Conceivability-Possibility Principles (CPs) have been a staple in philosophy of mind at least since Descartes. He used a CP to argue for the real distinction of mind and body in Meditation VI:

…because I know that everything I clearly and distinctly conceive can be made by God as I understand it, it is sufficient that I am able clearly and distinctly to conceive one thing apart from another to know with certainty that the one is different from the other – because they could be separated, at least by God… Consequently, from the fact that I know that I exist, and I notice at the same time that nothing else plainly belongs to my nature or essence except only that I am a thinking thing, I rightly conclude that my essence consists solely in being a thinking thing… [B]ecause I have on the one hand a clear and distinct idea of myself, insofar as I am merely a thinking thing and not extended, and on the other hand, a distinct idea of the body insofar as it is merely an extended thing and not thinking, it is certain that I am really distinct from my body, and can exist without it (AT VII, 78).

Descartes’ argument trades on three premises. First, clear and distinct conceivability is a reliable guide to possibility. In particular, if it is clearly and distinctly conceivable that x can exist apart from y, then it is possible for x to exist apart from y. Second, I can form a clear and distinct conception of myself apart from my body. Hence, I can exist without it. But third, if x can exist without y, then clearly x cannot be y. Hence, I cannot be my body. CPs have become controversial in part because of their association with arguments of this sort. Jackson’s (1982, 1986) knowledge argument and Searle’s (1980) Chinese Room argument as well as a host of other arguments concerning the possibility of inverted spectra, absent qualia, and the like trade on CPs.

Unrestricted CPs, ones that do not qualify the notion of conceivability or limit the scope of the modal operator, have clear counterexamples. Some of those counterexamples concern the scope of the operator. DaVinci, for instance, conceived of humans flying with birdlike wings despite the physical impossibility of such flight. Similarly, prior to the twentieth century people might have conceived that it was possible for there to be a solid uranium sphere with a mass exceeding 1,000 kg – another physical impossibility. Other counterexamples concern the notion of conceivability. It is unclear, for instance, whether the conceptions people form of things while drunk or drugged or in various other circumstances can serve as reliable guides to possibility.

Because of examples of this sort, exponents of CPs do not endorse unrestricted versions of them, but versions limited to a particular type of conceivability, a particular scope for the modal operator, and a particular subject matter for the claim or scenario being conceived. Descartes, for instance, spoke of clear and distinct conceivability, and took the scope of the modal operator to cover metaphysically possible worlds – or as he puts it, the range of circumstances God could have brought about. A CP along these lines is immune to counterexamples such as the uranium sphere and human birdlike flight since these examples pertain to nomological or physical possibility. Roughly, p is nomologically possible exactly if p is consistent with the laws of nature, and p is physically possible exactly if p is consistent with the laws of physics (physical possibility and nomological possibility are the same if the laws of physical are the same as the laws of nature). Since we can know these laws only through scientific investigation, it seems likely that our conceptions of nomological and physical possibilities can only be as reliable as our best scientific knowledge allows them to be. The same can be said of technological possibility or other kinds of possibility that involve consistency with conditions that are knowable only a posteriori.

Metaphysical possibility, on the other hand, involves compossibility with essences – the features things need to exist in any metaphysically possible world. Knowledge of essences does not necessarily depend on empirical considerations. Whether or not it does marks the difference between empirical essentialists and conceptual essentialists. Roughly, empirical essentialists claim that our knowledge of essences is analogous to our knowledge of the laws of physics or of nature: we can learn about them only a posteriori. Conceptual essentialists disagree: we can come to know essences a priori.

Descartes is a prototypical conceptual essentialist. He thinks it is possible to discover something’s essence by means of a certain kind of conceptual analysis. Consider, for instance, his argument in Meditation II that his essence consists in thinking alone:

Can I not affirm that I have at least a minimum of all those things which I have just said pertain to the nature of body? I attend to them… [N]othing comes to mind… Being nourished or moving? Since now I do not have a body, these surely are nothing but figments. Sensing? Surely this too does not happen without a body… Thinking? Here I discover it: It is thought; this alone cannot be separated from me… I am therefore precisely only a thinking thing… (AT VII, 26-27).

The procedure Descartes follows for forming a clear and distinct conception of something’s essence is roughly as follows. First, he reckons that the object in question has certain properties. He then considers whether it can exist without these properties by “removing” them from the object one-by-one in his thought or imagination. If he can conceive of the object existing without a certain property, he can conclude that that property does not belong to the object’s nature or essence. He thus takes himself to arrive by turns at a clearer, more distinct conception of what the object essentially is. When he applies this procedure to himself, he initially reckons that he has various bodily attributes such as having a face, hands, and arms, and being capable of eating, walking, perceiving, and thinking. He then considers whether he could still exist without these features by “removing” them from himself conceptually. He concludes that he could exist without all of them except the property of thinking. He can form no conception of himself without it, he says, whereas he can form a clear and distinct conception of himself without any bodily attributes. He concludes, therefore, that he can form a clear and distinct conception of himself as a thinking thing alone apart from his body or any other.

Conceptual essentialism was en vogue for a long time in modern philosophy, but empirical essentialism experienced a revival in the late twentieth century due to the work of Kripke (1972) and Putnam (1975b). According to empirical essentialists, discerning something’s essence is not a task that can be accomplished from an armchair. It requires actual scientific investigation since the conceptions we initially form of things may not correspond to their essential properties. We might have learned to identify water, for instance, by a certain characteristic look or smell or taste, but if we brought a bottle of water to a distant planet with a strange atmosphere that affected our senses in unusual ways, the contents of the bottle might no longer look, smell, or taste to us the same way. This would not mean that the substance in the bottle was no longer water; it would still be the same substance; it would simply be affecting our senses differently on account of the planet’s strange atmosphere. It would still be water, in other words, despite the fact that it did not have the characteristics we originally associated with water. The essential features of water would remain the same even if its “accidental” features underwent a change. According to empirical essentialists, the essential features of something, the features that enable us to claim that, for instance, the contents of the bottle are essentially the same on Earth and on the distant planet, are features it is up to science to discern — features which might not correspond to our intuitive, prescientific conception of water.

Empirical essentialists tend to be inhospitable to conceivability-possibility arguments of the sort represented by CA1 and CA2. They can attack the argument in the following ways. First, against CA1, they can argue that the conceivability of multiple realizability is a guide to possibility which is only as reliable as our best scientific knowledge of mental phenomena and their realizers, and that in its current incomplete state, our scientific knowledge does not provide us with the resources sufficient to act as a reliable guide to possibility in this matter. Against CA2, on the other hand, they can argue that in our current state of scientific knowledge we cannot conceive of mental types being multiply realizable for either of two reasons: (a) we don’t know enough about mental types and their realizers to form any clear conception of whether or not they are multiply realizable, or (b) we do know enough about mental types and their realizers to form a clear conception that they are not multiply realizable.

b. Empirical Arguments for the MRT

Empirical arguments for the MRT largely avoid the aforementioned worries concerning CPs. They generalize from findings in particular scientific disciplines. Various scientific disciplines, they claim, provide inductive grounds that support the possibility of mental types being realized by diverse physical types. Those disciplines include evolutionary biology, neuroscience, and cognitive science – artificial intelligence research in particular.

The argument Putnam (1967a) originally advanced against the identity theory is an example of an appeal to evolutionary biology. According to Putnam, what we know about evolution suggests that in all likelihood it is possible for a given mental type to be correlated with multiple diverse physical types. Block and Fodor (1972: 238) and Fodor (1968a; 1974) have advanced similar arguments.

We can formulate the appeal to biology in roughly the following way. The phenomenon of convergent evolution gives us good reason to suppose there are beings in the universe that are mentally similar to humans. One reason for this is that the possession of psychological capacities would seem to be (at least under certain circumstances) selectively advantageous. The ability to experience pain, for instance, would seem to increase my chances of survival if, say, I am in danger of being burned alive. The pain I experience would contribute to behavior aimed at removing the threat. Likewise, if I am in danger of being eaten by a large carnivore, my chances of survival will be enhanced if I am able to feel fear and to respond to the threat appropriately. Similarly, it is plausible to suppose that in many circumstances my chances of surviving and successfully reproducing will be improved by having more or less accurate beliefs about the environment – knowing or believing that fires and large carnivores are dangerous, for instance. There are, in short, many reasons for thinking that possessing mental states of the sort humans possess would be selectively advantageous for beings of other kinds. This gives us some reason to suppose that there might be beings in the universe that are very similar to us mentally. On the other hand, there are analogous reasons to suppose that those beings are probably very different from us physically. The last forty years of biological research have shown us that life can evolve in a broad range of very different environments. Environments once thought incapable of supporting life such as deep sea volcanic vents have been discovered to support rich and diverse ecosystems. It seems very likely, then, that living systems will be capable of evolving in a broad range of environments very different from those on Earth. In that case, however, it seems very unlikely that mentally-endowed creatures evolving in those environments will be physically just like humans. Our current state of biological knowledge suggests, then, that there are most likely beings in the universe who are like us mentally but who are unlike us physically. Evolutionary biology thus gives us some reason to suppose the MRT is true.

A second kind of argument appeals not to evolutionary biology but to neuroscience. One such argument, for instance, appeals to the phenomenon of brain plasticity (Block and Fodor 1972: 238; Fodor 1974: 104-106; Endicott 1993). Brain plasticity is the ability of various parts of the brain or nervous system to realize cognitive or motor abilities. (See Kolb and Whishaw 2003: 621-641 for a description of brain plasticity and research related to it.) If the section of motor cortex that controls, say, thumb movement is damaged, cells in the adjacent sections of cortex are able to take over the functions previously performed by the damaged ones. What this seems to suggest is that different neural components are capable of realizing the same type of cognitive operation. And this gives us some reason to suspect it is possible for tokens of one mental type to be realized by tokens of more than one physical type.

Finally, a third type of empirical argument appeals to work in artificial intelligence (AI) (Block and Fodor, op cit.; Fodor, op cit). Some AI researchers are in the business of constructing computer-based models of cognitive functioning. They construct computational systems that aim at mimicking various forms of human behavior such as linguistic understanding. Incremental success in this type of endeavor would lend further support to the idea that mental types could be realized by diverse physical types: not just by human brains but by silicon circuitry.

One criticism of empirical arguments for the MRT is that they are merely inductive in character (Zangwill 1992: 218-219): the denial of multiple realizability is still consistent with their premises. In addition, Shapiro (2004) argues against the appeal to biology on the grounds that a view which denies the MRT is just as probable given convergent evolution as a view which endorses it. Against the appeal to neuroscience, moreover, Bechtel and Mundale (1999) argue that the argument’s principle of brain state individuation is unrealistically narrow. Real neuroscientific practice individuates brain states more broadly. In addition, the neuroscientific data is compatible with there being a single determinable physical type which simply takes on multiple determinate forms (Hill 1991). Finally, the appeal to AI would seem to be little more than a promissory note. That work hasn’t produced anything approaching a being with psychological capacities like our own. The argument is thus little different from a conceptual argument for the MRT. Moreover, there are arguments purporting to show that silicon-based minds are impossible. Searle’s (1980) Chinese Room argument is an example.

3. Responses to the Antireductionist Argument

Reductionists have several ways of responding to the multiple-realizability argument. It will be helpful to divide them into two groups. Typology-based responses target Premises 1 and 2 of the antireductionist argument: the MRT and the claim that the MRT is incompatible with mental-physical type identities. Reduction-based responses, on the other hand, target Premise 3 of the antireductionist argument, the claim that mental-physical type identities are necessary for reduction. These responses will be discussed in order.

a. Typology-Based Responses

Typology-based responses to the multiple-realizability argument take the definition of ‘multiple realizability’ to include a condition relating types to specific typologies. A condition of this sort was left implicit in the definition of multiple realizability given in Section 1-c. An explicit statement of such a condition would take something like the following form:

[Def*] A type M is multiply realizable relative to typologies T and T* iff df. (i) M is a type postulated by T; (ii) P and Q are types postulated by T*; (iii) possiblyM, P-tokens are core realizers of M-tokens; (iv) possiblyM, Q-tokens are core realizers of M-tokens, and (v) PQ.

According to typology-based responses, the multiple-realizability argument trades on the unwarranted and highly dubious assumption that psychophysical relations must be reckoned only relative to our current mental and physical typologies. In all likelihood, they claim, future scientific investigation will result in the formulation of new mental and/or physical typologies which will no longer support the MRT or the claim that it implies the non-identity of mental and physical types.

Kim (1972), it seems, was the first to appreciate the range of typology-based strategies available to opponents of the multiple-realizability argument. They include the postulation of a new mental typology, the postulation of a new physical typology, and the postulation of both a new mental and a new physical typology. The first strategy includes the local reduction move. The second strategy includes the postulation of overarching physical commonalities, the postulation of broad physical types, and the disjunctive move. Finally, the third strategy includes the coordinated typology strategy, the idea that mental and physical typologies will develop in a coordinated way that yields one-one mental-physical type correlations. These options are represented in Figure 1.

mr-fig1

Figure 1: Typology-based Responses

Relative to our current mental and physical typologies, the MRT implies that a mental type, M, is correlated with multiple physical types P1,…,Pn as in Column I. Psychophysical identification requires, however, that each mental type line up with a single physical type. Reductionists can respond to the argument either by “breaking up” M into a number of “narrower” mental types M1,…,Mn each of which corresponds to a single physical type as in Column II. This is the strategy represented by the local reduction move. Reductionists can also respond, however, by “gathering” the diverse physical types together under a single overarching physical type, P, which corresponds to M as in Column III. This is the strategy represented by the postulation of overarching physical commonalities, the postulation of broad physical types, and the disjunctive move. Finally, reductionists can respond by claiming that mental and physical typologies will both be altered in various ways that eventually yield one-one correlations between mental and physical types as in Column IV.

Typology-based responses can be understood to target either Premise 1 or Premise 2 of the antireductionist argument. Which they are understood to target depends on whether any of the types in question are defined relative to our current typologies. Consider an example. Someone who claims that the mental types postulated by our current typology will be retained in a new typology alongside more “narrow” mental types which are correlated one-one with physical types will claim that that Premise 2 is false: the MRT is compatible with mental-physical type identities. By contrast, someone who claims that the mental types postulated by our current typology will not be retained in a new typology will claim instead that the MRT is false: all mental types are really of a narrow variety; each corresponds to a single physical type.

i. New Mental Typologies: The Local Reduction Move

The local reduction move (LRM) has also been called an appeal to ‘narrow mental types’, or to ‘species-specific’ or ‘structure-’ or ‘domain-specific reductions’. Its exponents include Kim (1972: 235; 1989; 1992), Lewis (1969, 1980), Enc (1983: 289-90), P.M. Churchland (1988: 40-41), P.S. Churchland (1986: 356-358), Causey (1977: 147-149), and Bickle (1998). According to the LRM, a mental predicate or term such as ‘pain’, which seems to express a single mental type, really expresses multiple diverse mental types. The case of ‘pain’ is analogous to the case of ‘jade’. The latter was originally taken to refer to a single mineralogical type. Scientific investigation revealed, however, that ‘jade’ really corresponds to two distinct mineralogical types: jadeite and nephrite. Exponents of the LRM claim that mental predicates and terms are the same way. ‘Pain’ doesn’t express a single overarching mental type found in humans, in Martians, and in robots; ‘pain’ is instead an imprecise term which corresponds to multiple diverse mental types including pain-in-humans, pain-in-Martians, and pain-in-robots. As a result, we shouldn’t be seeking to identify physical types with “broad” mental types such as pain; we should instead be seeking to identify them with “narrower” mental types such as pain-in-humans, pain-in-Martians, and pain-in-robots.

In support of the LRM, Enc (ibid.) has drawn an analogy with thermodynamics (cf. Churchland 1986 and Churchland 1988). Heat, he argues, is multiply realized at the level of microphysical interactions. Temperature-in-gases is different from temperature-in-solids, which is different from temperature-in-plasmas and temperature-in-a-vacuum. The multiple realizability of heat, however, does not imply that thermodynamics has not been reduced to statistical mechanics; it merely implies that the reduction proceeds piecemeal. Temperature-in-gases is identified with one type of mechanical property; temperature-in-plasmas, with a different mechanical property, and so on. Thermodynamics is thus reduced to statistical mechanics one lower-level domain at a time through the mediation of restricted domain-specific thermodynamic types: temperature-in-gases, temperature-in-solids, and the like. Something similar could be true of psychophysical reduction. Psychology could reduce to physical theory by way of various domain-specific mental types such as pain-in-humans and pain-in-Martians.

Several criticisms of the LRM have appeared in the literature. Zangwill (1992: 215), for instance, argues that the thermodynamic example is irrelevant to the philosophy of mind. Another criticism claims that narrower mental types would be too narrow for the explanatory purposes psychological discourse aims to satisfy (cf. Putnam 1975c: 295-298; Fodor 1974: 114; Pylyshyn 1984: Chapter 1; Endicott 1993: 311-312). Science seeks the broadest, most comprehensive generalizations it can get, the argument claims, but the LRM seems to violate this methodological canon since the narrow mental types it postulates would prevent us from formulating broad cross-species generalizations. Sober (1999) attacks the argument’s major premise: science doesn’t always work by seeking the broadest, most comprehensive generalizations. Moreover, even if narrow mental types didn’t allow for the formulation of the most comprehensive generalizations, we might still be better off with local reductions for a variety of reasons including ontological parsimony and the value of grounding higher-level explanations in mental-physical type identities. (Endicott 1993: 311). (Bickle 1998: 150ff. criticizes this objection to the LRM in other ways as well.)

A third criticism claims that the LRM would fail to explain what all the phenomena called ‘pain’ have in common (Block 1980b: 178-9). Against this, Kim (1992) has argued that diverse types such as pain-in-humans and pain-in-Martians would still have in common their satisfaction of a certain functional description or causal role, and this commonality would be sufficient to explain the commonalities among diverse instances of pain.

A final criticism of the LRM claims that there are no mental types narrow enough to line up with physical types in a way that would support reduction. Endicott (1993: 314-318) argues that if we postulate mental types narrow enough to avoid multiple realizability we risk postulating types that are so narrow it no longer makes sense to speak of a reduction of types as opposed to a mere identification of tokens. The burden for exponents of the LRM, then, is to postulate types with the right sort of grain: narrow enough to avoid the implications of the multiple-realizability argument, but not so narrow that the notion of reduction drops out of the picture. (Endicott (1993) criticizes the LRM in other ways as well.)

ii. New Physical Typologies I

Reductionists can also respond to the multiple-realizability argument by positing new physical typologies. Kim states the idea in the following terms:

…the mere fact that the physical bases of two nervous systems are different in material composition or physical organization with respect to a certain scheme of classification does not entail that they cannot be in the same physical state with respect to a different scheme (Kim 1972: 235).

At least three suggestions have been advanced in the literature to this effect. The first claims that we might discover something had in common by all of the apparently diverse realizers of a mental type. We could discover, for instance, that c-fiber firing in humans and q-fiber firing in Martians actually have something interesting in common – that they are in fact instances of a broader physical type which is correlated one-one with pain. According to this strategy, the diverse realizers of a mental type are analogous to electricity, magnetism, and light – types of phenomena which initially seemed diverse but which were later discovered to belong to a single overarching type.

Hill (1991: 105) suggests something like the postulation of overarching physical commonalities in the following terms:

[I]t is not enough to appeal to a case in which a single qualitative characteristic is associated with two or more distinct neurophysiological state-types. One must go on to provide an exhaustive characterization of the distinct levels of description and explanation that belong to neuroscience, and show that no such level harbors a kind under which all of the states in question may be subsumed (Hill 1991: 105).

Shapiro (2000, 2004) has a similar idea. Although aluminum and steel count as diverse types relative to one scheme of classification, he argues, they don’t count as diverse realizations of corkscrews because they have too much in common relative to the performance of the activities that qualify something as a corkscrew. (Gillett 2003 criticizes Shapiro’s argument.) Similarly, Bechtel and Mundale (1999) cite examples from cognitive neuroscience which suggest that there are lower-level properties which are nevertheless the same in a more general functional respect.

The discovery of overarching commonalities is not the only way of developing a new physical typology. Reductionists might decide to individuate realizing types in a way that comprises a broad swath of environmental factors. Antony and Levine (1997), for instance, argue that we should understand realization in terms of the total realizers of mental types instead of their core realizers (see Section 1-c). If realizers are individuated this broadly, however, mental types will no longer be multiply realizable.

Finally, reductionists could develop a new physical typology on the basis of disjunctive physical types. If reductionists are willing to countenance the existence of disjunctive properties, they could identify a mental type with the disjunction of its realizing types. This particular response to the multiple-realizability argument has generated an extensive literature, and deserves separate treatment.

iii. New Physical Typologies II: The Disjunctive Move

The possibility of identifying mental types with disjunctive physical types has repeatedly asserted itself in the literature on multiple realizability. Given an inventory of basic physical predicates P1,…,Pn the idea is to use Boolean operations to construct disjunctive predicates which express disjunctive types (e.g. P1vP3, P7vP15vP39). Putnam (1967) dismissed the disjunctive move out of hand, but it has since been taken very seriously. Kim (1978), Clapp (2001), and Antony (1998, 2003), for instance, have all defended it in one way or another.

Criticisms of the disjunctive move have been thoroughly discussed in the literature (Antony 1999, 2003; Antony and Levine 1997; Block 1980b, 1997; Block and Fodor 1972; Clapp 2001; Endicott 1991, 1993; Fodor 1974, 1997; Jaworski 2002; Kim 1972, 1978, 1984, 1992, 1998; Macdonald 1989; Melnyk 2003; Owens 1989; Pereboom 2002; Pereboom and Kornblith 1991; Putnam 1967a; Seager 1991; Teller 1983). The criticisms discussed in what follows fall into two broad categories: law-based criticisms and metaphysical criticisms. In discussing them, it will be helpful to introduce the following terms: if P1,…,Pn are the types that realize mental type M, call P1,…,Pn an R-disjunction, and call a generalization featuring an R-disjunction as its antecedent an R-disjunctive generalization.

1) Law-Based Criticisms

Law-based criticisms of the disjunctive move focus on the nature of scientific laws. They claim that predicates such as ‘believes’, ‘desires’, and ‘is in pain’ express genuine properties. If mental types are genuine properties, and mental types are identical to R-disjunctive types, then it follows by the indiscernibility of identicals that R-disjunctive types must be genuine properties as well. Fodor (1974) suggested, however, that genuine properties were expressed by the predicates of law statements – a plausible idea if genuine properties make a causal or explanatory difference to their bearers, and causal/explanatory regularities are expressed by law statements. Law-based criticisms of the disjunctive move argue that R-disjunctive generalizations are not genuine law statements, and because they are not genuine law statements, R-disjunctive predicates do not express genuine properties.

Methodological criticisms of the disjunctive move such as Fodor’s (1997: 157-9) claim that the postulation of R-disjunctive types violates standard canons of scientific method. Standard inductive practice aims at formulating the strongest generalizations warranted by the limited available evidence, and closed law statements, as Fodor calls them, are stronger than open ones. Closed law statements are law statements that do not feature open-ended disjunctive predicates such as a psychological generalization with the form ‘Necessarily, for any x, if Mx, then M*x’. Open law statements are law statements that do feature open-ended disjunctive predicates. An example would be an R-disjunctive generalization with the form ‘Necessarily, for any x, if P1x v P2x v… then M*x’. Given reasonable assumptions, the MRT implies that a given mental type will be correlated with an indefinitely large number of realizing types. Consequently, the MRT will most likely imply the existence of open generalizations of the latter sort as opposed to closed generalizations of the former one. Because scientific practice aims at formulating the strongest generalizations, and closed generalizations are stronger than open ones, standard scientific method dictates a preference for closed generalizations over open generalizations such as those featuring R-disjunctions. There are good methodological reasons, then, for supposing that R-disjunctive generalizations are not genuine law statements and that their predicates do not express genuine properties. The problem with this argument is that its point is merely methodological. It does not rule out the possibility of there being R-disjunctive types or R-disjunctive laws (a point Fodor recognizes). It thus falls short of refuting the disjunctive move.

Other law-based criticisms correspond to two different features of law statements: their ability to ground explanations, and their projectibility – their ability to be confirmed by their positive instances. Explanation-based criticisms of the disjunctive move claim that R-disjunctive generalizations cannot express laws because they do not function explanatorily the way law statements do. One such criticism claims, for instance, that explanations must be relevant to our explanatory interests, and appeals to R-disjunctive generalizations are clearly irrelevant to the interests we have in explaining human behavior (Pereboom and Kornblith 1991; Putnam 1975c, 1981). If, for instance, we want to know why Caesar ordered his troops to cross the Rubicon, it doesn’t satisfying our interests to respond, “Because he was either in neural state N1 or in neural state N2 or…” One criticism of this argument is that the notion of relevance is highly context dependent. Although there are good reasons to suppose appeals to R-disjunctive generalizations are irrelevant in “pedestrian” contexts such as the context involving Caesar’s actions, there are also good reasons to suppose that appeals to R-disjunctive generalizations might be relevant in scientific contexts in which reduction is at stake (Jaworski 2002).

Confirmation-based criticisms, on the other hand, claim that R-disjunctive generalizations cannot express laws because they are not confirmed in the way law statements are. In particular, they are not projectible; they are not confirmed by their positive instances. Exponents of confirmation-based criticisms include Owens (1989) and Seager (1990), but Kim’s (1992) version of this criticism is both the best developed and most widely discussed representative of this approach.

Kim’s argument trades on two premises. First, if some evidence e confirms p and p entails q, then e also confirms q. Second, no generalization can be confirmed without the observation of some of its positive instances. Given these premises, the argument purports to show that generalizations with disjunctive antecedents cannot express laws. If they did express laws, they would be confirmed by their positive instances the way all law statements are. But clearly they are not, the argument claims. To show this, assume for the sake of argument that generalizations with disjunctive antecedents are confirmed by their positive instances – call this the Disjunctive Confirmation Hypothesis. Consider now an example: every piece of jade, says Kim, is a piece of either jadeite or nephrite, and vice versa. Suppose, then, that a certain number of jadeite samples confirm the following:

(1) All jadeite is green.

Since each piece of jadeite is also a piece of jade (that is a piece of jadeite or nephrite) each piece of green jadeite is also a positive instance of (2):

(2) All jade is green (i.e. all jadeite or nephrite is green).

So if (1) is confirmed by the samples of jadeite, then by the Disjunctive Confirmation Hypothesis, so is (2). But ‘∀x((Jx v Nx) → Gx)’ implies ‘∀x(NxGx)’ in the predicate calculus, so if (2) is confirmed by the samples, then by Kim’s first premise, so is (3):

(3) All nephrite is green.

The problem, however, is that none of the samples are samples of nephrite. Because no generalization can be confirmed without the observation of some positive instances (Kim’s second premise), we must reject the assumption which sanctioned this confirmation procedure, namely the Disjunctive Confirmation Hypothesis. (A parallel example: suppose a sexually active adult is a sexually active man or woman, and that a certain number of sexually active men confirm ‘No sexually active man becomes pregnant’. Parity of reasoning yields the conclusion that those men confirm ‘No sexually active adult becomes pregnant’, and hence ‘No sexually active woman becomes pregnant’!) If the Disjunctive Confirmation Hypothesis is rejected, however, it follows that R-disjunctive generalizations fail to be confirmed in a lawlike manner and hence fail to express laws.

The principal shortcoming of this argument is that many disjunctive predicates are capable of occurring in law statements. Suppose, for instance, that ‘All emeralds are green’ expresses a law statement. Consider a term that is necessarily coextensive with ‘emeralds’ such as ‘emeralds in the northern hemisphere or elsewhere’. Since this term expresses the same class as ‘emeralds’ it seems that ‘All emeralds in the northern hemisphere or elsewhere are green’ will be confirmed by its positive instances if ‘All emeralds are green’ is. But if these are both law statements, then there will have to be some way of distinguishing legitimate disjunctive predicates such as ‘is a northern or a non-northern emerald’ from illegitimate disjunctive predicates such as ‘is jadeite or nephrite’, and it seems the only way of doing that is to consider the objects to which these predicates apply. Hence, says Kim, “There is nothing wrong with disjunctive predicates as such; the trouble arises when the kinds denoted by the disjoined predicates are heterogeneous… so that instances falling under them do not show the kind of ‘similarity’, or unity, that we expect of instances falling under a single kind” (Kim 1992: 321). A confirmation-based criticism seems to depend, therefore, on some type of metaphysical criticism.

2) Metaphysical Criticisms

Metaphysical criticisms of the disjunctive move claim the idea of a disjunctive property is somehow metaphysically suspect. There are at least two arguments of this sort.

Armstrong (1978: II, 20) argues that accepting disjunctive properties would violate the principle that the same property is present in its diverse instances. Objects a and b, for instance, might both have the disjunctive property PvQ despite the fact that a has it by virtue of having property P instead of Q, and b has it by virtue of having Q instead of P. Clapp (2001) criticizes this argument on the grounds that determinables and their corresponding determinates seem to provide counterexamples. For example, being red, being blue, being yellow, and so forth, are determinates of the determinable being colored. Since everything that is colored must be a determinate shade, anything that satisfies the predicate ‘is blue, or is red, or is yellow,…’ will also satisfy the predicate ‘is colored’. Consequently, if a is red and b is blue, they will have in common the property being colored.

A second metaphysical criticism argues that mental types cannot be identical to R-disjunctive types because R-disjunctions do not express natural kinds. One basic assumption of the multiple-realizability debate is that mental types are natural kinds. Consequently, if mental types are identical to R-disjunctive types, the latter must be natural kinds as well. But R-disjunctive types are not natural kinds, the argument claims. The reason is that natural kindhood is based on similarity, and instances of R-disjunctions are not similar to each other in the right sort of way (Fodor 1974: 109ff.; 1997: 156, Block 1978: 266, Macdonald 1989: 36-7, Armstrong 1978: Vol. II, 20, Kim 1992, Antony and Levine 1997: 87ff.).

Individual instances or members of a natural kind are similar in important ways that have a bearing on, for instance, the projectibility of law statements. The generalization ‘All Ks are F’ is projectible only if Ks remain similar across actual and counterfactual circumstances in ways that have a bearing on their F-ness. Only if Ks are similar to each other in these ways can the observation of any K provide evidence about the F-ness of any other K. Inductive projection about Ks requires, then, that Ks be similar to each other in stable ways. One version of this similarity-based argument understands the relevant similarity in terms of causality (Kim 1992). Kim labels this the “Principle of Causal Individuation of Kinds”: “Kinds in a science are individuated on the basis of causal powers; that is, objects and events fall under a kind, or share in a property, insofar as they have similar causal powers” (Kim 1992: 326). The argument, then, is that R-disjunctive types can qualify as natural kinds only if they are causally similar – only if, for instance, R-disjunctive tokens have similar effects. But, the argument claims, R-disjunctive tokens are not causally similar. If they were causally similar; if, for instance, c-fiber firing and q-fiber firing produced the same effects, they probably wouldn’t qualify as diverse realizers of pain. The causal diversity of R-disjunctive tokens seems to be an implication of the MRT. Consequently, R-disjunctive types are not natural kinds.

Criticisms of this argument have sometimes appealed to the considerations that support physical commonalities among R-disjuncts (See Section 3-a-iii). Block (1997), Antony and Levine (1997), Shapiro (2000), and others have argued, for instance, that diverse physical realizers must have something interesting in common in order to satisfy the functional descriptions associated with mental states. If being in pain amounts to being in some lower-order physical state with such-and-such typical effects, then c-fiber firing and q-fiber firing must each be able to produce those effects to qualify as instances of pain. They must therefore be causally similar to that extent at least. Importantly, critics of this argument have typically not sought to defend the disjunctive move per se, but rather implications the argument has for nonreductive physicalism (see Section 4 below.)

iv. Coordinate Typologies

Another typology-based response to the antireductionist argument claims that mental and physical typologies are to some extent interdependent, and as a result they will eventually converge in a way that yields one-one correlations between mental and physical types. Something like this idea is suggested by Kim:

The less the physical basis of the nervous system of some organisms resembles ours, the less temptation there will be for ascribing them sensations or other phenomenal events (Kim 1972: 235).

Similarly, Enc argues (1983: 290) that our mental typology will eventually be altered to reflect our lower-level scientific investigations. Couch (2004) makes a similar point: if scientists find physical differences among the parts of a system, they are likely to seek higher-level functional differences as well. (Cf. Hill 1991: Chapter 3.)

One argument in favor of coordinate typologies is suggested by Kim (1992), Bickle (1998: Chapter 4), and Bechtel and Mundale (1999). The idea is roughly that there can be higher-level regularities only if they are grounded in lower-level ones. Consequently, if we discuss higher-level regularities such as those expressed by familiar psychological generalizations, we have good reason to think these are underwritten by regularities at lower levels. This dependence of higher-level regularities on lower-level regularities gives us some reason to suspect that mental and physical typologies will tend to converge. (Sungsu Kim (2002) criticizes Bechtel and Mundale’s argument. Couch (2004) defends it.)

b. Reduction-Based Responses

Reduction-based responses to the multiple-realizability argument attack the claim that reduction requires bridge principles taking the form of identity statements. Robert Richardson (1979), for instance, argues that a Nagelian account of intertheoretic reduction can be underwritten by one-way conditionals. Consider again the theories TA and TB discussed in Section 1e. Imagine that TA is slated for reduction to TB, and that LA is a law statement of TA which is supposed to be derived from LB, a law statement of TB:

LA For any x, if A1(x), then A2(x);
LB For any x, if B1(x), then B2(x).

Since the vocabulary of TB does not include the predicates A1 or A2, additional premises linking the vocabularies of the two theories are required. Earlier, in Section 1-e, we said that the derivation of LA from LB required bridge principles taking the form of identity statements:

ID1A1 = B1
ID2A2 = B2;

It seems, however, that LA might be derived from LB on the basis of bridge principles along the following lines instead:

C1 Necessarily, for any x, if B1(x), then A1 (x);
C2 Necessarily, for any x, if B2 (x), then A2(x).

If one-way conditionals of this sort are sufficient for reductive derivations, then the non-identity of mental and physical types is not incompatible with reductionism after all. Reductive derivations might proceed via bridge principles such as C1 and C2 even if identity statements along the lines of ID1 and ID2 are false.

The problem with this understanding of reduction, one indicated by Patricia Kitcher (1980) in her criticism of Richardson, is that a derivation via one-way conditionals does not result in ontological simplification (cf. Bickle 1998: 119-120). It doesn’t show that what we originally took to be two kinds of entities are really only one. Ontological simplification of this sort is taken to be a central feature of reduction – the upshot of showing that A-entities are really just B-entities.

Reduction-based responses to the multiple-realizability argument have not been as popular as typology-based responses on account of widespread commitment to the idea that reduction involves ontological simplification (Sklar 1967; Schaffner 1967; Causey 1972; 1977: Chapter 4; Hooker 1981: Part III; Churchland 1986). Yet Bickle (2003) has recently suggested another type of reduction-based response. It claims not that bridge principles along the lines of C1 and C2 are sufficient for reduction, but that ontological issues concerning the identity or non-identity of properties are completely orthogonal to the issue of reduction. If that is the case, then issues concerning psychophysical reduction could be addressed independently of issues concerning the identity or non-identity of mental and physical types.

4. Multiple Realizability and Nonreductive Physicalism

Multiple realizability has recently played an important role in the attempt to articulate an acceptable form of nonreductive physicalism (NRP). NRP can be characterized by a commitment to three claims, roughly:

Physicalism: Everything is physical – all objects, properties, and events are the sort that can be exhaustively described and/or explained by the natural sciences.

Mental Realism: Some mental types are genuine properties.

Antireductionism: Mental and physical types are not identical.

Jaegwon Kim has articulated a well-known difficulty for a particular type of NRP: realization physicalism. Realization physicalism claims that properties postulated by nonphysical frameworks are higher-order properties that are realized by lower-order properties or their instances in the sense described in Section 1-b. Having a mental property amounts to having some lower-order property that satisfies a certain associated description or condition. Having pain, for instance, might be defined as having some lower-order property that is typically caused by pinpricks, abrasions, burns, and the like, and that typically causes wincing, groaning, and escape-directed movements. Here ‘…is typically caused by pinpricks, abrasions, burns… and typically causes wincing, groaning, escape-directed movements’ expresses the condition associated with being in pain. Any properties whose instances satisfy this causal profile count as instances of pain, and the lower-order properties (or property instances) that satisfy that condition are said to realize pain.

Kim argues that realization physicalism is an unstable theory: either its commitment to Mental Realism and Antireductionism imply a rejection of Physicalism, or else its commitment to Physicalism and Mental Realism imply a rejection of Antireductionism. His argument trades on two assumptions.

First, Kim assumes that genuine properties are ones that make a causal difference to their bearers. We can distinguish between two senses of ‘property’. Properties in a broad or latitudinarian sense are roughly the ontological correlates of predicates. Properties in a narrow, causal sense, on the other hand, are properties in the broad sense that make a causal difference to their bearers. Hence, weighing 1 kg and weighing 2.2 pounds are different properties in the broad sense since they correspond to different predicates, but they are not different properties in the causal sense since they are necessarily coextensive and influence the causal relations into which their bearers enter in exactly the same ways. One might even do well to eliminate talk of broad properties altogether, says Kim (1998: Chapter 4), and speak instead simply of properties in the causal sense which are expressible by different predicates. Hence, there is a single (causal) property expressed by the predicates ‘weighs 1 kg’ and ‘weighs 2.2 pounds’.

Second, Kim assumes that if physicalism is true, the only genuine (i.e. causal) properties that exist are physical properties. Denying this, he says, would be tantamount to denying physicalism; it would be to accept the existence of “emergent causal powers: causal powers that magically emerge at a higher level” (1992: 326).

Given these assumptions, Kim poses the following difficulty for realization physicalists. According to Antireductionism, mental types are not identical to physical types. In that case, however, it is unclear how mental types could manage to be genuine properties. If Physicalism is true, then all causal properties are physical. This seems to imply a principle along the following lines (it is stated here without the qualifications Kim adds):

If a higher-order property M is realized by a lower-order property P, then the causal powers of this instance of M are identical to the causal powers of P.

Kim (1992: 326) calls this the ‘Causal Inheritance Principle’. This principle would appear to present realization physicalists with an uncomfortable choice. They could (a) deny the causal status of mental types; that is, they could reject Mental Realism and deny that mental types are genuine properties. Alternatively, they could (b) reject Physicalism; that is, they could endorse the causal status of mental types, but deny their causal status derives from the causal status of their physical realizers. Or finally, they could (c) endorse Mental Realism and Physicalism, and reject Antireductionism. Given the assumption that mental types are genuine properties, a commitment to Physicalism would imply that mental types are identical to physical types. This is the option Kim favors. Kim is nevertheless sympathetic with the idea that the mental types postulated by our current mental typology are multiply realizable relative to the physical types postulated by our current physical typologies. He argues, moreover, that R-disjunctive types cannot be natural kinds for reasons discussed in Section 3-a-iii-3. If those types are not natural kinds, however, then we have good reason to suppose that the mental types postulated by our current mental typology are not natural kinds either. Each of those mental types is necessarily coextensive with an R-disjunction, and no mental type can have causal powers beyond those of the individual disjuncts. If those disjuncts are causally dissimilar, then instances of the corresponding mental type must be causally dissimilar as well. Suppose, however, that causal similarity is necessary for natural kind status. In that case, it follows that the mental types postulated by our current mental typology cannot be natural kinds. Consequently, Kim favors the local reduction move discussed in Section 3-a-i. We need a new mental typology that postulates new narrow mental types that are correlated one-one with physical types.

5. References and Further Reading

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  • Antony, Louise and Levine, Joseph. 1997. “Reduction with Autonomy.” In Tomberlin 1997.
  • Armstrong, D.M. 1968. A Materialist Theory of Mind. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
  • Armstrong, D.M. 1970. “The Nature of Mind.” In The Mind/Brain Identity Theory. C.V. Borst, ed. London: Macmillan, 67-79. Reprinted in Block 1980a, 191-199.
  • Armstrong, D.M. 1978. A Theory of Universals: Universals and Scientific Realism, Vol. II.. Cambridge University Press.
  • Bealer, George. 1994. “Mental Properties.” Journal of Philosophy 91: 185-208.
  • Bechtel, William and Jennifer Mundale. 1999. “Multiple Realizability Revisited: Linking Cognitive and Neural States.” Philosophy of Science, 66: 175-207.
  • Bickle, John. 1998. Psychoneural Reduction: The New Wave. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Bickle, John. 2003. Philosophy and Neuroscience: A Ruthlessly Reductive Account. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
  • Block, Ned. 1978. Troubles With Functionalism. In Perception and Cognition: Issues in the Foundations of Psychology. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. 9. C.W. Savage, ed. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 261-325.
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  • Block, Ned. 1980b. “What is Functionalism?” In Block 1980a: 171-84.
  • Block, Ned. 1997. “Anti-Reductionism Slaps Back.” In Tomberlin 1997: 107-32.
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Author Information

William Jaworski
Email: jaworski@fordham.edu
Fordham University
U. S. A.

Liezi (Lieh-tzu, cn. 4th cn. B.C.E.)

The Liezi (Lieh-tzu), or Master Lie may be considered to be the third of the Chinese philosophical texts in the line of thought represented by the Laozi and the Zhuangzi, subsequently classified as Daojia (“the School of the Way”) or Daoist philosophy. Whether Master Lie existed as an actual person or not, the text bears his name in order to indicate its adherence to the line of thought and practice associated with this name. This appears to be true of other early texts, such as the Laozi, the Heguanzi, and the Guiguzi, for example. Despite the controversy over its dating and authorship, this is a philosophical treatise that clearly stands in the same tradition as the Zhuangzi, dealing with many of the same issues, and on occasion with almost identical passages. The Liezi continues the line of philosophical thinking of the Xiao Yao You, and the Qiu Shui, from which it takes up the themes of transcending boundaries, spirit journeying, cultivation of equanimity, and acceptance of the vicissitudes of life. It also continues the line of thought of the Yang Sheng Zhu, and the Da Sheng, developing the theme of cultivating extreme subtlety of perception and extraordinary levels of skill. It is noteworthy that the Liezi stands out as more apparently metaphysical than the cosmologically oriented texts of the Zhou and Han dynasties (such as the Laozi, Zhong Yong, and the Xici of the Yijing). That is, it goes further towards explicitly articulating a conception of the ‘transcendent’ or ‘metaphysical’: that which is beyond the realm of observable things that come into and go out of existence, and that is prior to, superior to, and responsible for it as its necessary condition. While the Liezi does not unambiguously articulate the logical conditions that define transcendence as such (a necessarily asymmetrical relation of dependence between the world and its source), still, the traces of transcendence are intriguing and worth philosophical investigation.

Table of Contents

  1. Historical Background
  2. The Liezi Text
  3. Central Concepts in the Liezi
    1. Chapter 1: Tian Rui (Omens of Nature)
    2. Chapter 2: Huang Di (The Yellow Emperor)
    3. Chapter 3: Zhou Mu Wang (King Mu of Zhou)
    4. Chapter 4: Zhong Ni (Confucius)
    5. Chapter 5: Tang Wen (The Questions of Tang)
    6. Chapter 6: Li Ming (Effort and Circumstance)
    7. Chapter 7: Yang Zhu (Yang Zhu)
    8. Chapter 8: Shuo Fu (Explaining the Signs)
  4. Key Interpreters of Liezi
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

The character after whom the text is named is called Lie Yukou; his personal name, “Yukou,” means ‘guard-against-bandits.’ According to the Liezi itself, he lived in the Butian game preserve in the principality of Zheng, but was eventually driven by famine to live in Wei. The first chapter of the Zhuangzi refers to Liezi, and so, if this character corresponds to a really existing person, he must have existed prior to the writing of that chapter. This means that Liezi would have flourished some time before the end of the fourth century BCE. W. T. Chan places him as early as the fifth century. He was said to have been a student of Huzi (Huqiu Zilin), and a fellow student of Bohun Wuren (wuren: “no person”), and teacher of Baifeng. However, it is not clear whether there ever really existed a philosopher named ‘Liezi.’ Liezi is not explicitly mentioned in any of the early classifications of philosophical schools: those of Xunzi, Zhuangzi’s Tianxia chapter, and Sima Qian. Moreover, the character is understood to be an adept with superhuman powers. Zhuangzi, for example, says that he had the ability to fly for fifteen days at a time. Yang Bojun insists that, despite the mythologizing of the character, there is sufficient scattered evidence that there probably did exist a real person on whom the stories were based. Nevertheless, scholars have for centuries been suspicious of the existence of Master Lie, and of the authenticity of the text.

The ideas expressed throughout the text have clear affinities with the philosophies expressed in the Laozi and the Zhuangzi, and so categorizing these three as belonging to roughly the same tradition of thought is not problematic—even if the authors, contributors, and commentators did not think of themselves as proponents of a single doctrine, or as belonging to the same ‘school’. The Laozi is sometimes quoted with approval, although the quotations are attributed either to the Book of the Yellow Emperor, or to Lao Dan. While the Liezi does not refer to the Zhuangzi, it shows clear signs of influence from the latter (even though the character Liezi is supposed to have lived before Zhuangzi). This indicates a later dating of much, if not all, of the text.

Unlike the Laozi, this text displays little interest in critiquing the Ruists or Confucians, and unlike the Zhuangzi, does not criticize the ‘Ru Mo’—the Ruists and Mohists. On the contrary, it shows signs of reconciliation of Ruist and Daoist ideas: many Ruist principles are given Daoist interpretation, and Confucius appears in several stories as a wise and sympathetic character, if not a sage. Incidentally, that one of the chapters of the text is named after Confucius should not, by itself, be taken as significant. The chapter is so named, solely because the name of Confucius appears at the beginning of the first story. This eclectic reconciliation of Ruism, Daoism, and on occasion Mohism, is indication of the post-Qin provenance of the relevant passages.

While Zhuangzi’s own philosophy is believed to have exerted a significant influence on the interpretation of Buddhism in China, the Liezi may constitute a possible converse case of Mahayana Buddhist influence on the development of the ideas of Zhuangzi. Stories here and there resonate with some of the tenets of Sanlun (the Chinese form of Madhyamaka), Weishilun (the Chinese form of Yogacara), and Huayan. The resonances are highly suggestive, but the evidence is not decisive enough to be sure of any influence, either of Buddhist ideas on the Liezi, or vice versa. If the conjecture of Buddhist influence is correct, it would also place the relevant passages of the text well into, if not after, the Han dynasty.

2. The Liezi Text

The text, like many other early Chinese ‘books,’ is a collection of various materials, written at different times, some of which can also be found in other sources. Liu Xiang, the Western Han scholar, says in his preface that he edited and collated material from twenty chapters distributed in other collections, and reduced them to eight by eliminating excess materials. The extant eight chapter version, with Zhang Zhan’s commentary, dates from the Western Jin (approximately three centuries later).

Each chapter contains a series of stories, each developing some theme whose antecedents can often be discerned from the Laozi or the Zhuangzi. Several themes are developed in each chapter, and some chapters overlap in themes, but as with the Zhuangzi, each chapter has its distinctive ‘feel’. About one quarter of the text consists of passages that can be found in other early works, such as the Zhuangzi, the Huainanzi, and the Lüshi Chunqiu. The remaining majority of the text, however, is distinctive in style, and with the exception of the “Yang Zhu” chapter quite consistent in the world view and way of life that it expresses. Most of the text contains material of philosophical interest. However, myths and folk tales based on similar themes, but with no apparent philosophical value, can be found side by side with stories that have profound philosophical significance.

The “Yang Zhu” chapter is problematic. While the earliest reference to the text (Liu Xiang) lists a chapter with the title, the currently extant version of this chapter has little to nothing in common with the rest of the book, and indeed espouses a hedonist philosophy of pleasure seeking that is inconsistent with the cultivation of indifference toward worldly things that is characteristic of much of the rest of the book, and of the Zhuang-Lie approach to Daoism in general.

The “authenticity” of the Liezi text has been challenged by Chinese scholars for centuries, and it has accordingly been taken by perhaps a majority of scholars to be a forgery. Their claim is that the textual material was compiled, edited, and written by a single author who intended to deceive readers into believing that this was an ancient text. Certainly, the text is an eclectic compilation consisting of early materials which can be found in other texts, together with original material dating from well after the time period from which its supposed author is said to have lived. However, as Zhuang Wanshou points out, the characteristics cited for classifying the text as a forgery—being composed by several authors over several centuries, and drawing from several sources—apply to other philosophical texts which are not dismissed as “forgeries,” including, for example, the Analects and the Zhuangzi. Moreover, it is not clear why this should be considered sufficient reason to reject, and neglect, the Liezi as a philosophical text. Moreover, from a purely philosophical point of view, whoever wrote the text, and whenever it was written, it contains much material that expresses distinctively recognizable strands of Lao-Zhuang thought, with sufficient complexity and sophistication to warrant serious study as the third of the important Daoist philosophical texts.

3. Central Concepts in the Liezi

a. Chapter 1: Tian Rui (Omens of Nature)

In the opening chapter of the Liezi we can identify the beginnings of an articulation of a concept of a ‘beyond’ (wai) that bears a striking resemblance to Western concepts of the “transcendent” or “metaphysical.” I mean these terms more or less synonymously, and in the strong philosophical sense of: that which lies beyond the realm of experience, and stands independently as its necessary condition. The idea of a ‘beyond’ occurs several times, in different formulations, but it is unclear how close this gets to the Western concept of a metaphysical transcendent. In particular, while the formulations suggest an asymmetric relation of dependence—namely, that a realm beyond the conditions of existing things is itself a necessary condition for the existing, changing, things that we encounter, and not vice versa—it does not clearly and explicitly assert it as a necessarily asymmetrical relation. Still, this chapter goes much further than the Laozi or the Zhuangzi toward articulating anything like this sort of transcendence, and so if we are going to claim to find anything like it in the Daoist tradition, our best bet is with the Liezi.

The chapter begins with an account of something that is the condition of the existence of living and changing things. At first glance, this appears to define a metaphysical beyond that can only be hinted at negatively: that which is beyond birth and transformation (the unborn/not-living, busheng, and the unchanging, buhua), and which is responsible for all birth and transformation. It is the unborn that is able to produce the living, and the unchanging that is able to change the changing. This strongly suggests a dependence of the living on the unborn, of the changing on the unchanging. However, while the text explicitly asserts that the unborn/not-living can produce the living, it does not explicitly deny the opposite. Without this explicit assertion of necessary asymmetry, it has not, strictly speaking, claimed a transcendent role for the unborn/unchanging. Thus, the passage can still be read as entirely consistent with the typical Daoist claim that the stages of living and not living, and of change and not changing, are interdependent contrasts, each giving rise to the other.

The chapter also contains an explicit cosmology (a philosophical account of the basic makeup of the world), and, asks about the beginnings of heaven and earth. The text postulates several great beginnings, (taiyi, taichu, taishi, taisu), which successively mark an undifferentiated stage, a stage of energy (qi), a stage of embodied form (xing), and a stage of intrinsic stuff (zhi). The energies (or perhaps forms, or stuff, the text is not explicit) divide into two kinds: the light becomes the ‘heavens’ (tian), the heavy becomes the earth, and the blending of the two becomes the human realm. Here again, with questions about ‘great origins,’ we sense a possible concern with transcendence, but everything that is explicitly stated is compatible with an organic, naturalistic cosmology, and does not require the imposition of the full-blooded concept of metaphysical transcendence.

There follows an intriguing passage in which it is stated that that which produces, shapes, and colors, has not yet tasted, existed, or appeared. Here, an attempt is made to articulate a distinction between a realm of form that has perceptible properties, and a realm prior to form, shape, smell, etc which is responsible for these, and which itself does not have these perceptible properties. This passage is significant, because in this case, an asymmetry is for the first time explicitly articulated. However, the asymmetry is not asserted as a necessity, but merely as a contingent fact, thus still leaving room for interpreting the producer and the produced as interdependent.

After considering the cosmic beginnings, the chapter ends with a discussion of the possible end of the world. If the heavens (and the earth) are accumulated qi, then why might they not eventually come apart? Several answers are considered: they couldn’t come apart, because they are qi of a specific kind. Or: they could come apart, but that is so far off it is not something we need worry about. Or: It is beyond our knowledge whether they could ever come apart. Finally, Liezi’s answer is that both alternatives are “nonsense”: to say that tiandi will perish is nonsense, and to say that it won’t is nonsense. While the logic of this answer is left incomplete, it reminds us of the logic of the Sanlun philosophy of Madhyamaka Buddhism. The Sanlun philosophy tries to articulate a rejection of simplistic dichotomies, and encourages a third way (a ‘middle path’) that involves transcending the perspective from which we must choose between such dichotomies. There are other places in the Liezi where these hints of Sanlun emerge more explicitly, suggesting the possibility of Buddhist influence, and thereby a later dating of the text (or at least of these passages). It is worth noting, however, that the anti-metaphysical stance of Madhyamaka Buddhism is inconsistent with the positing of a realm of transcendence—thereby complicating the issue still further.

b. Chapter 2: Huang Di (The Yellow Emperor)

The Daoists are known for extolling the marvellous abilities of people with extraordinary skills, and the Liezi is no exception. Stories abound of people who perform breathtaking, sometimes life-threatening, feats with tranquil ease and flawless artistry. While these people are not directly called sages, they are nevertheless looked up to as exemplary of the ideals of the Daoist way of life.

What they have is extraordinary ability, but it is not to be understood mere daring or bravery; nor is it to be understood as qiao, skill, dexterity, or craftsmanship, in the ordinary sense of those terms. It is not simply a matter of technique, but rather of inner cultivation. These abilities arise when one understands and follows the natures or tendencies of things, and it is an understanding that cannot be put into words. As such, it is not something that one consciously knows: one might say, using the language of Polanyi, that it is a form of “tacit knowing.” Liezi emphasizes the point with examples of unwitting sages, people who naturally have a potent ability, and yet have no idea of how extraordinary they are, and indeed whose ignorance is in some cases the necessary condition of their exceptional abilities.

In other cases, or for other people, years of fasting, training, and discipline are necessary to cultivate such abilities. To engage successfully with things requires penetrating through to the inner tendencies of things, to that which lies at the root of things, beyond their observable shape and form. The sage unifies his nature (xing), energies, and potency, with a single-minded concentration on the task at hand, aware of nothing except the circumstances and the goal, and is subtly in tune with the innermost core of things. When one is able, in this way, to penetrate to the place where things are ‘forged’, one is no longer at their mercy, and then the extremes of life’s circumstances cannot ‘enter’ (ru) to disturb one’s tranquility.

c. Chapter 3: Zhou Mu Wang (King Mu of Zhou)

What is waking experience, or dream experience? What is the relation between them? From a realist perspective, only waking experience is experience of reality, while dream experience is an ‘imaginary’ reproduction of the experiences without there being a corresponding dream reality. From an idealist perspective, the difference is less radical. It is, to a large extent, a difference in degree, rather than in kind. Waking experience is simply more coherent and more enduring, and is shared by others. What, then, if there were a kind of dream experience that was more coherent and more enduring? How would we draw the distinction then? What if there a kind of dream experience that could be shared with others? Would this not constitute a radical challenge to the distinction between waking and dreaming?

It is notable that the term huan is used to talk of the status of dreams, and thereby also of our waking experience to the extent that it too is considered to be dreamlike. The term means ‘illusion’, and suggests a very strong devaluation of what we ordinarily take to be genuine experience. In some sense, all experience is for us a magnificent, magical display, a phantasmagoria of sensory delights and horrors. Seen in this light, dream and waking experience become equalized: the reality of dreams is of the same order as the illusory nature of waking experience. From an idealist perspective of this sort, waking experience is ultimately no different from a dream. This is reminiscent of the Vedanta conception of maya, and indeed it is noteworthy that huan is the word standardly used to translate the Buddhist concept of maya. If it is the case, as most scholars argue, that there is no evidence of an indigenous Chinese tradition developing a distinction between the realms of ‘Appearance’ and ‘Reality’, then this would seem to indicate the possibility of Indian influence, most probably via the Yogacara incorporation of Vedanta philosophical concepts, imparted through its Chinese form of Weishilun.

d. Chapter 4: Zhong Ni (Confucius)

In the opening of this chapter, Confucius is found lamenting his lack of success in life, and his beloved disciple Yan Hui reminds him to cultivate indifference. Confucius responds in a manner that attempts to provide a reconciliation of Daoist virtue and cultivation with Ruist social involvement. Thus, coming to terms with tian and ming means more than simply accepting everything that happens to us with equanimity or indifference. Equanimity means rejoicing in nothing, but to rejoice in nothing requires rejoicing equally in everything. And to rejoice equally in everything requires being fully immersed in each and every one of our concerns, in our successes and failures. Thus, it is entirely appropriate, and consistent with Liezi’s form of Daoism, for Confucius to grieve that he did not succeed, during his lifetime, in transforming the state. This is a very clever reinterpretation of the Daoist cultivation of equanimity that makes it compatible with care and concern for social ventures. It takes Daoist logic that leads us away from worldliness, and follows it through so that it leads us right back into the thick of things. In doing so, it anticipates the Chan (Zen) response to Huayan Buddhism.

The intuitive ‘non-knowing’ of the Huang Di chapter is then applied to the subject of governing in order to describe a Daoist kind of ‘mystical’ rulership. One rules most skilfully by doing ‘nothing.’ The ruler cultivates an intuitive sensitivity to the natures of people and circumstances, and becomes so sensitive to all that happens that he or she can respond appropriately, without necessarily knowing, or consciously planning, or taking deliberate control, or making crude judgments regarding what is right and what is wrong.

e. Chapter 5: Tang Wen (The Questions of Tang)

This chapter opens up another kind of metaphysical problem: the problem of what things are like ‘outside’ of the realms of familiarity, and gives expression to a sense of the magnificence of the world: vast, unencompassable dimensions, and the extraordinary variety of things, creatures, cultures, and places. The problem is posed, and different answers are suggested, but I think it would be a mistake to try to find a consistent metaphysical position asserted as the correct one. Rather, the text engages in a literary-philosophical exploration of some possibilities. Also, several implications are explored, drawing together concepts from other chapters: sameness and difference, the vast and the petty, the infinite and inexhaustible, the skill of the imperceptible.

As we move from region to region throughout its boundless extent, we meet up with increasingly strange varieties of things. Yet despite their differences, are they after all just variations on a theme? All things are different, and yet is it not also the case that all things are in a deeper sense the same? In either case, to one who is truly at home in the universe, the extraordinary and wonderful varieties are remarkable but not to be considered weird. Thus, unlike our typical tendency to marvel at the peculiar weirdness of the ‘exotic,’ this chapter encourages us to de-exoticize the unfamiliar.

Going beyond the limits is conceived not simply as moving outwards along a trajectory, but as occuring between levels of containment. To go outside, or beyond, is to move to a higher level within which the previous level is contained. But this very movement immediately suggests the possibility of iteration, and thus leads to the Daoist formulation of a problem concerning finitude. Are there ultimate limits of containment to how far we can go beyond? If so, is there such a thing as what is beyond those limits? Or is the process limitless? If so, can there be such a thing as what is beyond the limitless?

Conversely, the ‘inexhaustible’ refers to movement in the opposite direction, inwardly from the vast to the minuscule. At its extreme, the inexhaustible, infinitesimal within things, approaches nothing. The more subtle and minuscule it gets, the more it escapes the purview of ordinary sensory awareness. It is the inexhaustible subtleties within things that enable things to be what they are, and so sensitivity to such subtleties can and should be cultivated. Since such an awareness is unavailable to ordinary perception, and since as we have seen in Chapter 2 it is also non-verbal, it is thought of as a kind of intuitive embodied insight that remains beneath the level of conscious awareness. When we cultivate this, we are able to sense the innermost tendencies of things, respond to changes before they manifest, and thus act without interfering. The sagely charioteer, for example, does not force the horses to move, nor fight the terrain, but has a subtle sensitivity to the terrain, and to the every movement of the horses, and is able to guide, even to “control”, merely by following intuitively, tacitly, the tendencies of things.

This distinction between the vast and the petty also has more familiar, less mystical application. Great things can be achieved by focusing on the here and now: no need for a long term plan, for far reaching vision. Just keep doing what you can, no matter how dense and shortsighted: the results will take care of themselves. Great things can thus be achieved unwittingly, stupidly even. Hence, the stupid man is able to move the mountain.

f. Chapter 6: Li Ming (Effort and Circumstance)

The chapter raises the question: to what must we attribute the vicissitudes of life, our successes and failures? Is it really something that is in our control, that can be changed by li, human effort? Or is it, after all, just circumstance, ming, in this case not inappropriately interpreted as ‘fate’? That is, is it something our efforts can affect, or is it something we can do nothing about?

In the Zhuangzi, an answer is given that is reminiscent of Stoicism: that the circumstances into which we emerge are simply the way things are. We must learn to accept our lot, ming, with equanimity. There appear to be two answers given in the Liezi, one of which, given at the end of the chapter, echoes this answer of Zhuangzi. But at the beginning of the chapter, the two alternatives of li and ming are rejected. Instead, the answer is given that we must learn to accept that whatever happens, it is just the way things are, Gu. In fact, these two answers are not different, since the sense being expressed by gu in the Liezi is precisely what is expressed by the word ming in the Zhuangzi. The answer to this problem lies in the fact that the word ming has two senses. In the Zhuangzi and other early texts, ming is the circumstances that surround us, the way things are. It also has aspects of the following senses: life, lifespan, lot (in life), calling, naming, command, circumstance, that into which we are thrown, and with which we must come to terms. Insofar as this does not necessarily imply an external determining force, it differs from the concept of ‘fate.’

But it also may be used in a less sophisticated sense to refer to an external force which is in control of things, that is “fate” or “destiny”. This sense of the word can be found as early as the Mozi, in the Fei Ming (Against Fate) chapter. When the Liezi contrasts li and ming, it is in this cruder sense that ming is being rejected. Instead, the word gu is used in this text as a synonym for what was expressed by ming in the Zhuangzi. What is being denied, then, in these passages is that neither effort, nor any external force of destiny is truly in control of what happens. Thus, it is the dichotomy of personal control vs external control that is being rejected: it is not that success or failure is determined by us, nor is it the case that success or failure is determined by external circumstances. Nor, incidentally, is the point that there is always a combination of both effort and circumstance. Rather, whatever effort is involved, and whatever the circumstances, in all cases it is always a matter of how things just happened to turn out. In the end, even if neither effort nor circumstance determine the outcome, yet the outcome has simply followed its gu, the way it is.

g. Chapter 7: Yang Zhu (Yang Zhu)

The ideas of this chapter are so inconsistent with the rest of the text that it is clearly out of place. Exactly how and why it made its way into this collection, and succeeded in remaining there, is unclear. It espouses a hedonistic philosophy: Life is short; Live for pleasure alone; Don’t waste time cultivating virtues. If it bears any relation to Daoist philosophy, then it appears to be a sophomoric misunderstanding of the ideas of the Xiao Yao You chapter of the Zhuangzi. Graham suggests that it comes from a former Yangist phase of the author’s philosophical career, and that it was written, in part, to provide a foil against which to understand his later philosophy.

h. Chapter 8: Shuo Fu (Explaining the Signs)

This chapter is a mixed collection of stories, exploring themes of varying philosophical significance. A recurring theme expresses a particularist attitude that might be thought of as a kind of casuistry (according to which judgments are made by comparing the particularities of individual cases), or contextualism (according to which judgments ought to be made only when all differences of context are factored in). Several stories are told, in each of which we have apparently similar circumstances in which the outcome varies significantly. The point is to emphasize that we cannot simply assume that what appear to be similar situations require similar responses from us. We must treat each case in the light of its own unique circumstances. That is, instead of looking for simple rules to be applied at all times, we must instead learn how to read the subtleties of the ‘signs’. This may be done either through a clear and explicit awareness that arises from careful observation, or through an intuitive and embodied understanding that arises from familiarity and practice.

4. Key Interpreters of Liezi

The first eight chapter edition of the text may have been edited and compiled by Liu Xiang (77—6BCE). If this edition ever existed, it is no longer extant. Zhang Zhan’s annotated edition (around 370 CE) became popular from the Tang dynasty, and this edition with Zhang’s commentary has become the received version. A second philosophical commentary was produced by Lu Chongxuan in the 8th century). After the Tang, doubts began to be raised about its authenticity, beginning with Liu Zongyuan (773—819). Unfortunately, most of the scholarly discussion around this text has concerned its dating and “authenticity,” and consequently, there has been little to no serious interpretation of the text regarding its philosophical content.

The concern to dismiss the text increased in the early twentieth century. In 1919, Ma Shulun argued that it was a forgery made by students of Wang Bi, stealing materials from many prior philosophical sources. In 1920, Takeuchi Yoshio published a refutation of Ma Shulun, but acknowledged that the text was a late compilation. In 1949, Cen Zhongmian, attempted to defend the text, using modern techniques of linguistic analysis to argue that it dated from the late Zhou, but his argument has not been influential. In 1927, Liang Qichao even suggested that it was in fact the commentator Zhang Zhan himself who forged the book.

In 1979, two excellent editions of the Liezi with important critical commentaries were published: one by Yang Bojun in Beijing, the other by Zhuang Wanshou in Taibei. It is important to note that Zhuang’s so-called Du Ben not merely a study book, but is a significant work in its own right.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Barrett, T. H. “Lieh Tzu.” In Early Chinese Texts: A Bibliographical Guide, ed. Michael Loewe (Berkeley: Society for the Study of Early China and the Institute of East Asian Studies, University of California, Berkeley, 1993), 298-308.
  • Graham, A. C. The Book of Lieh-tzu. New York: Columbia University Press, 1960.
  • Graham, A. C. “The Date and Composition of the Lieh-Tzu.” In Studies in Chinese Philosophy and Philosophical Literature (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1990), 216-282.
  • Yang, Bojun. Liezi Jishi. Beijing: Zhonghua Shuju, 1979.
  • Wieger, Leo. Taoism: The Philosophy of China. Burbank, CA: Ohara Publications, 1976.
  • Zhuang, Wanshou. Xinyi Liezi Duben. Taibei: Sanmin Shuju, 1979.

Author Information

Steve Coutinho
Email: coutinho@muhlenberg.edu
Muhlenberg College
U. S. A.

Resurrection

The term “resurrection” refers to the raising of someone from the dead. The resurrection of the dead brings to the forefront topics from the study of personal identity and philosophical anthropology. For example, some people think that we have souls and that the souls play an important role in resurrection. Others claim that we do not have souls and that this is a reason to deny that there is any life after death. In addition, the study of resurrection has benefited from interaction with topics in contemporary metaphysics. There are many puzzles about how things survive change. Philosophers have taken insights and distinctions from those cases and used them in their discussion of resurrection.

The article begins with a brief overview of the doctrine of the resurrection. It touches on the essential parts of the Christian doctrine and points to some of the surrounding controversies. The most common objection to the Christian doctrine of the resurrection of the dead is that it cannot be made compatible with materialism, the claim that humans are material beings and have no non-physical parts. This article examines the supposed inconsistency and looks at four different attempts by philosophers to advance a coherent account of the doctrine of the resurrection. The conclusion is a brief look at immaterialist accounts of resurrection and a summary and criticism of John W. Cooper’s argument that the Christian belief in an intermediate state entails mind-body dualism.

Table of Contents

  1. The Christian Doctrine of Resurrection
  2. Objections to the Christian Doctrine of Resurrection
  3. Materialist Accounts of Resurrection
    1. The Simulacra Model
    2. The Constitution View
    3. The Falling Elevator Model
    4. Anti-Criterialism
  4. Immaterialists Accounts of Resurrection
    1. Augustine and Aquinas
    2. The Intermediate State
  5. References and Further Reading

1. The Christian Doctrine of Resurrection

Many different religions have accounts of life after death but the Christian doctrine of the resurrection of the dead has received the most attention by philosophers. This is in large part due to the centrality of the doctrine in the Western religious tradition. Because of the emphasis on Christian accounts of resurrection in the philosophical literature, this entry will focus on the debates about the Christian doctrine of resurrection. However, much of what is said can be applied to other religions and traditions. To see a contemporary non-Christian account of resurrection, see John Leslie’s Immortality Defended.

The raising of the dead plays a central role in Christian belief. To begin with, Christians believe that Jesus died and rose from the dead. Each of the four gospels contains testimony about the resurrection of Jesus (see Matthew 28:1-20, Mark 16:1-8, Luke 24:1-53, and John 20:1-21:25). Jesus’ resurrection is central to Christian belief because on it rests claims about Jesus’ divinity and various doctrines about salvation.

There is a fair amount of scholarly work done on the question of whether or not Jesus did rise from the dead. This debate falls outside the scope of the article but the interested reader will find The Son Rises: The Historical Evidence for the Resurrection of Jesus by William Craig and Did Jesus Rise From the Dead? The Resurrection Debate by Gary Habermas, Anthony Flew, and Terry Miethe to be good starting points.

Christians believe that Jesus’ resurrection serves as a model for the resurrection of some people (perhaps everyone) in the future. It is this belief that is known as the Christian doctrine of the resurrection of the dead (henceforth CDR). To be clear, this doctrine is one of bodily resurrection. It is not a claim about figurative or metaphorical resurrection. We will now look at various aspects of CDR.

First, one might wonder about the scope of CDR. Who, exactly, will be raised from the dead? By far, the majority of Christians (lay people, clergy, and scholars) have believed that both Christians and non-Christians will be resurrected. In addition, it has been believed that this resurrection is not the same for everyone. For example, some believe that Christians will be raised in a new spiritual body that will experience an eternity of blessing, while non-Christians will be raised so that they might undergo judgment and punishment.

Two doctrines that are compatible with a denial that both Christians and non-Christians will be resurrected are annihilationism and conditional immortality. Annihilationism is the view that non-Christians are not punished for eternity but rather are annihilated. Some versions of annihilationism hold that God will punish unrepentant sinners for a limited time in hell and then annihilate them (thus, endorsing some sort of afterlife) while others hold that sinners are not resurrected at all. Conditional immortality is the view that the soul is not inherently immortal and that it is only God’s gift that grants the soul eternal life. Both of these views are held by a small minority of evangelical Protestants and various Adventist churches.

Proponents of the resurrection of the godly and the ungodly point to scripture in support of their belief in a general resurrection. For example, in Acts 24:15 it is reported that Paul believed that “there shall certainly be a resurrection of both the righteous and the wicked” (all verses quoted are from the New American Standard Bible translation, NASB). In addition to the verse in Acts the reader can also look to Daniel 12:2 and Revelation 20:13-15 for support of the belief in a general resurrection. In any case, it must be acknowledged that historically and scripturally the bulk of attention is placed on the resurrection of the believer. Thus, while CDR’s scope may include the non-believer, it is primarily a doctrine about what happens to the believer in the afterlife.

Second, one might wonder about the timing of the resurrection in CDR. When will the dead be raised? This is a contentious issue among Christian theologians and the timing of the resurrection (or resurrections) is largely determined by whether one is an amillennialist, postmillennialist, or premillenialist. Amillenialists believe that Jesus will return to earth and at that time the resurrection of the dead will take place along with the establishment of the New Heaven and the New Earth. Postmillennialists believe that there will be a “millennial age,” which need not be a thousand years long, characterized by Christianity becoming the dominant religion and the world turning towards God. At the end of this age, Christ will return and the resurrection of the dead will take place. Finally, premillenialists hold that the resurrection of the believers will occur when Christ returns to earth. Following Christ’s return, there will be a millennial age in which Christ reigns on earth. At the end of this time, among other things, the resurrection of unbelievers will occur and the New Heaven and New Earth will be established. (This last characterization is a simplification. There are some versions of premillenialism in which more than two large scale resurrections take place.)

Third, one might wonder about the nature of the resurrection in CDR. What will people be like once they are raised from the dead? After all, if someone was merely restored to his or her physical state right before death, then in many cases death would occur immediately afterwards. First, CDR teaches that the resurrection will be a physical or bodily resurrection. For example, Paul writes in Romans 8:11 that “He who raised Christ Jesus from the dead will also give life to your mortal bodies through His Spirit who dwells in you.” Additionally, Paul writes in 1 Corinthians 15:42-44:

So also is the resurrection of the dead. It is sown a perishable body, it is raised an imperishable body; it is sown in dishonor, it is raised in glory; it is sown in weakness, it is raised in power; it is sown a natural body, it is raised a spiritual body.

Also, Christians cite the example of Jesus after his resurrection. Jesus is depicted not as some ghostly figure but as an embodied person, able to eat, drink, and physically interact with others.

Second, the depictions of the resurrected Christ in the gospels and the scripture passages above indicate that the body that will be raised will be significantly different than the one that died. In Christ’s case people who knew him before he died had difficulty recognizing him after he died. However, they did recognize him after some prompting. (See John 20:11-18 for a case of this.) Additionally, while Paul contrasts the two bodies in the passage from Corinthians above, the New Testament also indicates that believers will be able to recognize one another. (See Matthew 8:11, 27:52-53 and Luke 9:30-33.)

We can now sum up what the core of CDR is. CDR is a doctrine that claims believers will be resurrected in bodily form when Christ returns to the earth. Christians disagree about the timing of Christ’s return, the particulars about the resurrected body, and the scope of the resurrection. However, the creeds have been consistent in affirming the essential parts of CDR. The Apostles Creed, written around the third or fourth century C.E., affirms “the resurrection of the body.” The Nicene Creed, C.E. 325, reads “I look for the resurrection of the dead, and the life of the world to come.” Additionally, various confessions and doctrinal statements have overwhelmingly endorsed CDR. For example, in the Westminster Confession of Faith, composed in 1643-46, there is a section on the resurrection of the dead which includes the claim that “all the dead shall be raised up, with the selfsame bodies, and none other (although with different qualities)….”

2. Objections to the Christian Doctrine of Resurrection

In this section of the article two objections to the Christian doctrine of resurrection (CDR) will be examined. First, the relationship between CDR and miracles will be discussed. Second, we will consider the claim that CDR is incompatible with materialism. The majority of this section will focus on the second objection because it is a) the most common objection to CDR and b) specific to CDR and not applicable to any number of different doctrines, unlike the first objection involving miracles. Ultimately, it will be suggested that the difficulties that CDR has with materialism are not due to a particular conflict with materialism. Instead, whether one is a dualist or a materialist supporter of CDR, one must account for how a material object can be numerically identical with a previous material object that was destroyed.

One objection to CDR is that it requires a miracle to take place. The objector presumably believes either that God would not perform such miraculous events or cannot perform such events. This sort of objection was more popular in the early to mid-20th century when many leading theologians and philosophers believed that the notion of a miracle was incoherent and that Christianity would be better off without a commitment to such overt supernatural events. Note that this sort of objection applies not only to CDR but to large parts of traditional Christian doctrine.

Defenders of CDR will admit that it would take a miracle for God to bring about the resurrection of the dead. However, the defenders of CDR do not see this as a problem. Rather, they embrace the coherence of the concept of a miracle, and argue that we are within our epistemic rights to believe in miracles. Recently, the position that Christianity has within it the resources to justify belief in miracles has become more popular among philosophers. If this position is true, then the defender of CDR is within her epistemic rights in believing that a supernatural act of God is required for a resurrection to occur. However, this does not mean that CDR is true. The opponent of CDR can still argue that CDR is false because it is committed to the existence of miracles. Of course, the opponent of CDR in raising this objection is also calling into question the greater theological scheme of which CDR is but a part. Therefore, any criticism of CDR’s commitment to miracles quickly escalates into a discussion about the truth of Christianity.

The most common objection to CDR is that it is incompatible with materialism. Since materialism is the predominant view of philosophers, this objection is taken to be a serious blow to both CDR and Christianity. In order to understand this objection, one must understand the distinction between qualitative and numerical identity.

Suppose one day that you hear the following comments: “Joe is wearing the same watch that he wore yesterday,” and “Joe is wearing the same watch that Amy is wearing.” Both of these comments make use of the phrase, “same watch,” but mean very different things. The first comment says that Joe is wearing a watch that is numerically identical to the watch he wore the day before. If Joe bought a warranty for the watch he was wearing yesterday, that warranty would apply to the watch he is wearing today. The first speaker is not talking of two different watches; he is talking of only one watch. The second speaker is not talking of one watch but of two. The speaker is claiming that the watch Joe is wearing is qualitatively identical to the watch that Amy is wearing. The two watches are such that they are of the same brand, have similar features, are of the same color, etc. If Joe were to purchase a warranty for the watch he is wearing, it would not apply to the watch that Amy is wearing. This case of watches generalizes to other objects. If object X is numerically identical to object Y, then there are not, in fact, two objects, but just one. For example, Superman is numerically identical to Clark Kent; there is just one person who happens to lead an interesting double life. If object X is qualitatively identical to object Y, then there are two objects that happen to be exactly alike in their various properties and qualities. For example, two electrons might be thought of as being qualitatively identical even though they are not numerically identical.

Note that very few pairs of things are qualitatively identical in a strict and philosophical sense. For example, we might speak of two desks of being “the same desk.” However, it is likely they have enough differences that they are not qualitatively identical. Rather, they are just very similar. They are qualitatively alike and for almost any purpose one of the desks will do just as well as the other. Additionally, almost all numerically distinct objects are qualitatively distinct as well. For, take any two numerically distinct objects, unless they occupy the very same space, we could say that one has the property of being in such and such a location and the other lacks that property.

If CDR is true, then there will be many people in the far future that will be resurrected. We can ask of each of these people, is he or she the same person who died? In asking this question we are not asking if they are qualitatively the same person. As we saw above, CDR claims that those that are resurrected will have very different bodies than they had before death. Furthermore, this change is unproblematic. People can undergo a vast amount of qualitative change in their present life and still be the same person. For example, a person can be involved in a terrible accident that leaves him or her both physically and mentally very different. However, we would still consider that person to be the same person, numerically speaking, as the person who was in the accident, despite the change he or she endured. So, when we ask whether or not the resurrected persons are the same persons who died, we are asking if they are numerically identical to someone who lived in the past.

This question is problematic for the proponent of CDR. Suppose the answer is no, then it seems as if CDR is an empty hope for those who believe in it. For, the Christian does not merely believe that someone like her will be resurrected, but believes that she will be the one who is resurrected in the future. Thus, CDR is committed to the claim that there must be some way for resurrection to occur that allows for numerical identity between a person before death and after resurrection.

The dualist seems to have an easier time meeting this commitment. Under many dualist views, a person is identical to a soul or some sort of non-physical entity. During a person’s life, one soul is “attached” or associated with one particular body. When death occurs, the dualist thinks that the soul and the body become “detached.” Later, when the resurrection of the dead occurs, the soul becomes attached to a new body. This is unproblematic because a person is not identical to the body but to the soul. The newly resurrected person is identical to someone who existed before because the soul is identical to a soul that existed before.

It seems it is more difficult for a materialist to give an account of resurrection that accounts for the numerical identity of persons before and after death. To see this, we will first look at a case involving the destruction and recreation of an everyday object and then apply that case to the materialist believer of CDR. The following case is taken from Peter van Inwagen (p.45). Consider an everyday material object, such as a book or a manuscript. Suppose that at some point in the past this manuscript was burned. Now, what would you think if someone told you that he or she was currently in possession of the very same manuscript that was burned in the past? Van Inwagen would find this incredible. He does not doubt that someone could possess an exact duplicate of the manuscript. He denies that anyone could possess a manuscript that was numerically identical to the one that was burned.

Suppose the owner of the manuscript tried to convince van Inwagen that it was possible for it to be the same one by describing a scenario in which God rebuilds the manuscript using the same atoms or other bits of matter that used to compose the manuscript. Van Inwagen claims that the manuscript God recreated is merely a duplicate. A duplicate is an object that is merely qualitatively identical to another object. Van Inwagen is not alone in thinking this. John Perry expresses this intuition in his work A Dialogue on Personal Identity and Immortality. In it, a character of his argues that Kleenex boxes cannot be rebuilt after being completely destroyed. Underlying these intuitions is the view that mere rebuilding of an object (even using the same parts) is not enough to insure that the object after rebuilding is numerically identical to the object before rebuilding.

Applying this intuition to the materialist we can see why CDR seems to be in conflict with materialism. For, materialism holds that people are material objects like manuscripts and Kleenex boxes. Thus, if a person’s body is destroyed then a person is destroyed and God can no better rebuild a person’s body than he can a manuscript or any other material object.

In response to this argument, the defender of CDR may reject the intuition behind van Inwagen’s argument and claim that God can rebuild material objects as long as he is using the same parts that composed the object when it is destroyed. Under this picture, the reassembly view of resurrection, God would resurrect people by assembling together all the bits of matter that used to be a part of their bodies and bringing them together again to form healthy bodies. The reader may wonder what is meant by “parts” or “bits of matter” in this discussion. Specification of these terms will vary depending on the proponent of the reassembly view, but typically the parts under consideration are the basic micro-physical parts that we are made of. For example, it would be a poor reassembly view of resurrection that held that God resurrected people by gathering all the organs that composed people at a previous time. After all, our organs will decay and decompose in a similar way that our bodies will. The protons, neutrons, electrons, quarks, superstrings, or whatever subatomic particle you choose will not decay in the same way, and presumably would survive into the future so that God might eventually gather them and reassemble them.

There are objections to the view of resurrection as assembly that go beyond the intuition that reassembly of a body is not enough to ensure that a reassembled person is numerically identical to someone in the past. First, it is not clear that all the parts that compose people now will exist later when the time for resurrection comes. It seems possible, if not plausible, that God would not be able to resurrect some people if the reassembly view was true. The defender of CDR would not be comfortable with such an outcome. Second, parts of people can become parts of other people. For example, when a cannibal bites into her latest victim, she digests and incorporates the parts of one person into her own person. God would not be able to rebuild everyone given the existence of cannibals and other mechanisms that allow parts of one person to become parts of another person after death.

For the reasons above, philosophers have tended to reject reassembly views. (For an account of the medieval debates about reassembly views and resurrection see Caroline Walker Bynum’s The Resurrection of the Body. Some of the defenses of reassembly views by medieval apologists are entertaining if not persuasive.) We are left with our original problem, how can a material object be rebuilt? If materialism is true, then how is resurrection possible? The remaining sections of this article explain several different ways in which philosophers have attempted to answer this question.

It should be noted that the argument against the materialist defender of CDR can be transformed slightly to apply to any defender of CDR. In the description of CDR the article left open the question of whether or not the resurrected body is numerically identical to the body pre-death. Many Christians think that it is true that a numerically identical body is resurrected. Trenton Merricks makes this case forcefully in his article “The Resurrection of the Body and the Life Everlasting.” There he argues that a) “the overwhelming majority of theologians and philosophers in the history of the church have endorsed the claim of numerical identity” (p. 268) and b) that scripture teaches this. In defense of his second point he points to 1 Corinthians 15 and the fact that Christ bore the scars of crucifixion. If Merricks is right, and numerical identity of the body is part of CDR, then a believer in CDR must defend the view that it is possible for God to resurrect a material object even if one is a dualist. If Merricks is not right, then the dualist has an easier time coming up with an account of resurrection than the materialist.

3. Materialist Accounts of Resurrection

a. The Simulacra Model

Peter van Inwagen has presented a model of resurrection that is compatible with materialism and the Christian doctrine of resurrection (CDR). The key problem for the defender of CDR is that once we die our bodies begin to disintegrate and eventually are destroyed by natural processes. Once this happens, it seems that even God cannot bring back that body because it is a logically impossible thing to do, given the intuition discussed above. Van Inwagen proposes solving this problem by giving an account of resurrection where our bodies do not in fact undergo decay. Under his account, “at the moment of each man’s death, God removes his corpse and replaces it with a simulacrum, which is what is burned or rots” (van Inwagen, p. 49). Later, at the time of the general resurrection, God will take the corpse that he has preserved and restore it to life.

One objection that van Inwagen addresses in his article is that there is no reason for God to replace genuine corpses with simulacra. If God does preserve our corpse, why does he not preserve it here on earth or remove the corpse from the earth without a replacement? Van Inwagen’s brief answer is that if God did not provide a simulacrum, then there would be widespread irrefutable evidence of the supernatural. Suppose someone put a torch to a corpse. If God were preserving that corpse, then no amount of effort would allow the natural process of cremation to take place. Van Inwagen goes on to say that there are good reasons for God to have a policy of not providing regular evidence of the supernatural (though in the article above van Inwagen is not specific about what those reasons are.)

Another objection to the simulacrum view is that it makes God out to be a great deceiver. We tend to think of the corpses that we bury or cremate as genuine corpses. Further, we have every reason to suspect that this is the case. If we are wrong, it is only due to God’s constant effort to deceive us. (See Hudson, p. 181, for a discussion of this point.)

Finally, it can be objected that the simulacrum view is incredible. Even though it is coherent, it requires us to adopt radically different beliefs than we currently hold. Van Inwagen acknowledges this point and in a postscript to his original article writes:

I am inclined now to think of the description that I gave in ‘The Possibility of Resurrection’ of how an omnipotent being could accomplish the Resurrection of the Dead as a ‘just-so story’: Although it serves to establish a possibility, it probably isn’t true (p.51).

He goes on to remark that while the theory itself might not be literally true, it is true in another way in that it shows us some important features about how God will accomplish the resurrection of the dead.

b. The Constitution View

In the other sections of the article, we have assumed that a materialist is someone who holds the view that not only is a person a material object but that a person is identical to a material object, namely her body. Some materialists deny this. Instead, they hold that a person is constituted by her body and that this relation is not one of identity.

By looking at a statue and the matter it is composed of we can better understand the constitution view. Consider a hunk of marble; let us call that hunk “Hunk”. Suppose Hunk is carved into a wonderful statue which we call “Statue.” Arguably, Statue and Hunk are not identical for Hunk has properties that Statue lacks. Hunk, for example, can survive being carved into a different statue while Statue cannot. Statue cannot exist without an artworld, while Hunk can, etc. Thus, by Leibniz’s Law, Statue and Hunk are not identical. However, we can say that Statue is constituted by Hunk. (Lynne Rudder Baker argues for this view in Persons and Bodies.)

Given the constitution view of persons, we can construct an account of resurrection that purports to solve the problems of the reassembly view we described earlier. In her paper “Need a Christian be a Mind/Body Dualist, Baker claims that at the general resurrection God will take some, not all, of the atoms that used to constitute a person, let’s call him Smith, and recreate Smith’s body. The difference between this and the reassembly view is that what God is recreating is not Smith but merely a body that constitutes Smith. Thus, while we are inclined to agree with van Inwagen that we do not have numerically identical body here, Baker suggests that we should think we have the same person here. For, unlike in the case of the manuscript, God can “simply will (it seems to [Baker]) there to be a body that has the complexity to ‘subserve’ Smith’s characteristic states, and that is suitably related to Smith’s biological body, to constitute Smith” (Baker, 1995, p. 499).

One might raise several objections to this view. First, it seems that the constitutionalist has to concede that the body raised in glory is not the same one that is sown in weakness. One constitutionalist, Kevin Corcoran, shows that the constitutionalist can avoid this consequence by combining the view expressed above with the falling elevator account discussed in the following section.

Second, one might object that this view is merely a replay of the reassembly view. After all, what makes this new person Smith and not some replica? According to Baker, it is that “what makes Smith the person she is are her characteristic intentional states, including first-person reference to her body” (1995, p. 499). Unlike inanimate objects, such as manuscripts, persons can survive by having a material object constitute a mental life that has the suitable characteristics. The thing constituting a person does not need to have a particular origin, as in the case of van Inwagen’s manuscript.

One can follow up this reply by asking: What would happen if God were to reassemble several bodies, all of which are exactly like the body God created for Smith? It seems like Baker is committed to them all being identical to Smith, which is absurd. Baker responds to this objection by claming that we can trust in God’s goodness to not bring this situation about.

Finally, some would object that this view commits us to a controversial metaphysics, namely that of the constitutionalist ontology. Exploring in detail this objection would go well outside the scope of the present article. Rather, the reader should keep in mind that this model of resurrection does require one to adopt an ontology that many philosophers find disagreeable. (See Hudson for one metaphysician who has argued against constitutionalism.)

c. The Falling Elevator Model

One serious problem with the simulacra view is its commitment to mass deception by God. Recall that under this view none of the corpses we see here on Earth are genuine corpses. They are bodies that have never been alive and were not even around until God placed them, like movie props, on the earth. Dean Zimmerman, in his paper “The Compatibility of Materialism and Survival: The ‘Falling Elevator’ Model” has offered the materialist (he is not one himself) an account of resurrection that avoids the problems of both reassembly views and the simulacra view. The origins of the name “the falling elevator model” or the “jumping animals account” is due to the propensity of cartoon characters to avoid death in a falling elevator by jumping out at the last minute. In the same way, in the falling elevator model, bodies “jump” at the last second before death to avoid being destroyed.

According to the falling elevator model at the point just before death God enables a person to undergo fission. (An object undergoes a case of fission when it splits, like an amoeba, into two objects, both of which bear a causal relationship to the original object.) One body resulting from this case of fission goes on to die and becomes a genuine corpse. The second body is transported by God into the far future where it goes on to be resurrected. Both of these bodies have an immanent-causal connection to the body just before death and it is this connection that supports the claim that the resurrected person is identical with the person who died and the claim that the corpse is a genuine corpse and not a simulacrum.

The main objection to this view is that it is committed to denying the “only x and y principle.” This principle has many variants, but it basically states that the only things that matter when considering whether or not x is numerically identical to y are the intrinsic properties of x and y and the relationships between them. The falling elevator model violates this principle because it allows for there to be cases of fission where at one time there are two persons that are both alive and have an immanent-causal connection to a previous person. To see this, consider a case where this occurs and there are two people “Joe” and “Fred” who both have an immanent-causal connection to a previous person “Mark.” Since the causal connection between Joe and Mark and the causal connection between Fred and Mark are both of the sort used by the proponent of the falling elevator model, the proponent is forced to acknowledge that both Joe and Fred are numerically identical to Mark. But that can’t be! Joe and Fred are not numerically identical to one another, and the identity relationship is transitive. Thus, the proponent of the falling elevator model will have to insist that some other criteria, outside Joe, Fred, and Mark, be used to evaluate personal identity. For example, the proponent will likely say that an object x is numerically identical to a previous object y only if x is the closest continuer to y at that time. Thus, we have a violation of the only x and y principle.

Hudson adopts the falling elevator model but avoids the consequence of rejecting the “only x and y principle” by endorsing a perdurantist view of persons. According to the perdurantist, people are not wholly located at a particular time. Rather, they are spread out over time and are composed of temporal parts. In the case above, the perdurantist would not say that Joe and Fred are numerically identical to Mark. Instead, he would claim that the temporal parts of Joe and Fred are related to the temporal part of Mark in such a way that the object composed of Joe and Mark is a person and the object composed of Fred and Mark is a different person. Granted, these two persons overlap for the entirety of the temporal part Mark, but that is not an incoherent outcome.

Perdurantism is a controversial metaphysics. A full discussion of it falls outside the scope of this article. The reader should bear in mind that if one adopts Hudson’s view, one also has to adopt metaphysical theses that are criticized by a wide variety of philosophers.

d. Anti-Criterialism

In order to understand the motivations for anti-criterialism, it will help if we look at a puzzle known as the Ship of Theseus. The Ship of Theseus is a story about a ship captain, named Theseus, who slowly replaces each one of the parts of his ship with a new part. This change is gradual, and many are inclined to believe that at the end of the process the repaired ship (call it ship A) is numerically identical to the one he began with (see the distinction between numerical and qualitative identity in section 2). Suppose that someone were to reassemble the parts that were replaced and form a new ship (call it ship B). Would ship B also be numerically identical to the original ship? Again, many think so. Since identity is a transitive relationship it cannot be that both ships A and B are identical to the original ship. This poses a puzzle for us, as we have the intuitions that ships can both survive a replacement of their parts and can be disassembled and reassembled.

Faced with puzzles such as the Ship of Theseus, and the possibility of fission (a case where one object divides into two, such as an amoeba splitting into two amoebas), philosophers have tended to adopt criterialism. Criterialism is the claim that there are criteria for identity over time. One recent philosopher to deny this is Trenton Merricks. In this section of the article we will look at Merricks’ position and see how he applies it to the objections to the Christian doctrine of resurrection (CDR).

A criterion for identity over time is a criterion for a particular type of object that gives informative necessary and sufficient conditions for numerical identity over time. For example, if you possessed a criterion for identity over time for ships, then you would be able to say what it is about a ship at the present time that makes it identical to a ship that existed previously. Some philosophers think that such criteria are useful because having them would allow us to solve puzzles that involve questions regarding an objects identity over time. For example, a criterion for ships would help us solve the Ship of Theseus paradox by allowing us to determine whether or not ship A or ship B is numerically identical to the original ship.

Let us now look some models given for CDR. Van Inwagen, for example, believes that the criterion of identity over time for persons is that a person at a given time must be part of the same life as a person at a previous time. Hudson argues for what he calls a psychological criterion of personal identity. Given these criteria, each philosopher attempts to construct a model of resurrection that does not violate his or her criterion for personal identity. (It should be noted that Baker, a constitutionalist, does not think we can give a criterion of personal identity. This seems to be because the criterion is mysterious, and not because there is no criterion. While her model of resurrection appears under a different section in this article, the reader is encouraged to think about how an adoption of anti-criterialism might be used to defend a constitutionalist account of resurrection.)

The main objection to CDR was that there was no coherent account of resurrection in which the persons or bodies resurrected were numerically identical to persons or bodies before death. Note that there was very little argument behind this objection. Rather, the burden of proof was on the proponent of CDR to provide a “just-so” story that showed how it was possible for us to be resurrected. Underlying this assumption was the belief that there is some criterion of personal identity and the intuition that no story about resurrection can accommodate this criterion.

One might be able to shift the burden of proof away from the proponent of CDR by denying that there is any criterion of personal identity. Merricks does just this. He denies that there are any criteria of identity over time for any object. Further, he claims that he does not have an account of resurrection and that lacking such an account is no problem for the believer of CDR. It is now up to the opponent of CDR to say why CDR is impossible. Since there are no criteria of personal identity, this task will prove difficult if not impossible. Of course, the anti-criterialist might wish, along with the rest of us, that we knew how God will resurrect us. But this lack of knowledge merely shows that we are ignorant of how resurrection occurs, not that resurrection is impossible.

The main objection to this view of resurrection centers on the denial of criterialism. As in the case of constitutionalism and perdurantism, an account of the objections to this metaphysical thesis falls outside the scope of this article. However, the reader is encouraged to look at Dean Zimmerman’s paper “Criteria of Identity and the ‘Identity Mystics’” for one response to anti-criterialism.

4. Immaterialists Accounts of Resurrection

a. Augustine and Aquinas

Of course, not all Christians are materialists and in this section we will look briefly at two types of accounts of immaterialist resurrection. Note that by an “immaterialist account,” we mean an account that entails that materialism is false. Aquinas, for example, is an immaterialist in this sense even though he did not think that we are identical to our soul or essentially an immaterial object. Most of the contemporary literature on resurrection focuses on material accounts because a) many philosophers find the concept of an immaterial soul mysterious at best and b) the most common objection to the Christian doctrine of resurrection (CDR) involves its incompatibility with materialism. The reader should not take the current state of the literature to be a guide to the philosophical merits of either materialist or immaterialist accounts or the proportion of Christians who hold to each position.

One of the most popular forms of dualism held by Christians has been a dualism inspired by Plato and Descartes in which 1) the soul and body are separate substances, 2) the soul is immaterial, and 3) the soul is identical to or strongly connected to the mind. One of the early Christian adopters of this view was Augustine. He modified arguments from Plato’s Phaedo to show that the soul must be immortal. Additionally, he argued that the soul must be immortal because it desires perfect happiness. The desire for perfect happiness includes a desire for immortality because no happiness would be perfect if one feared losing it at death. This desire is a natural desire, and thus, Augustine claimed, the soul must naturally be immortal. Bonaventure later takes up this argument when he argues for the immortality of the soul. (See the Copleston reference for more details about Augustine, Bonaventure and Aquinas).

One contemporary philosopher who defends a dualism of mind and body in the Augustinian tradition is Richard Swinburne. Swinburne compares the soul to a light and the body to a light bulb. In his view, if our bodies are destroyed then the soul would naturally cease to function in the same way that a light would naturally go out when a light bulb is destroyed. However, he thinks it is within God’s power to “fix the light bulb” and restore the functioning of the soul by providing a new body or some other means. For example, God could by a miraculous divine act cause souls to function while disembodied. In any case, Swinburne emphasizes that the soul is not by nature immortal (this goes against Augustine). Swinburne’s view is compatible with the doctrine of an intermediate state (see 4.b below) but denies Merricks’ claim that we will have numerically the same body when we are resurrected. Swinburne himself thinks that there is no intermediate state.

Many contemporary Christian dualists are similar to Swinburne. They agree that a) the soul is not by nature immortal, b) the doctrine of the intermediate state is compatible with dualism, and c) we will receive new bodies at the time of the general resurrection and our souls will be “hooked up” to these bodies by a divine act. Disagreements among Cartesian dualist Christians tend to revolve around the origin of the soul and the way in which the soul interacts with the body. For example, William Hasker in his article “Emergentism” argues that the soul is generated by the body while Swinburne believes souls are created by God.

Some Christian immaterialists are not Platonic/Cartesian dualists but rather are dualists in the spirit of Thomas Aquinas. Aquinas held the hylomorphic view that persons are a composite substance of matter and form. The substantial form, that which makes someone a substance, is the rational soul. Among those who held to a hylomorphic view, there was a debate about whether or not the soul could survive death, and, if it could, whether or not this ensures a personal resurrection.

Unlike some hylomorphists (perhaps Aristotle) he argues that the human mind or soul can exist apart from the body. The human mind is not dependent on the body because the way in which it knows depends upon its state. So, instead of ceasing to exist when becoming disembodied, the soul would merely come to know the world in a different way. Additionally, Aquinas argued that we can look forward to a personal resurrection. While the various human souls are nearly identical, we can individuate them in virtue of the bodies they did have on Earth and will have in the general resurrection.

b. The Intermediate State

A Christian belief that is related to the doctrine of resurrection is the belief in an intermediate state. Many Christians believe that between the time of death and the time of resurrection there is an intermediate state at which people will continue to exist. This section of the article will look at accounts of this intermediate state and examine an argument for dualism based on the intermediate state.

It should be pointed out that Protestants and Catholics differ significantly on the nature of the intermediate state. Traditional Catholic thought holds that some people go to purgatory when they die, as opposed to ceasing to exist or immediately going to exist in the presence of God. Purgatory is a place where souls go to be cleansed of sin before entrance to heaven. Believers are encouraged to pray for those souls that are in purgatory so that the souls might escape purgatory sooner. Catholics find support for the doctrine of purgatory in 2 Maccabees 12:42-45 and in church tradition. Protestants reject the doctrine of purgatory because they deny that 2 Maccabees is an authoritative source and because they claim the doctrine of purgatory contradicts scripture. Additionally, some Catholics have held to a belief in Limbus Patrum, a place where Old Testament saints went to await the death and resurrection of Christ, and Limbus Infantum, a place where unbaptized infants go after death.

In addition to the above controversies, Christians debate the fate of believers after death. Many think that believers retain consciousness and go into the presence of God. Proponents of the intermediate state point to passages in the New Testament in support of the view. For example, 2 Corinthians 5:6-8 reads:

Therefore, being of good courage, and knowing that while we are at home in the body we are absent from the Lord…we are of good courage, I say, and prefer rather to be absent from the body and to be at home with the Lord.

Additionally, Jesus says to the thief in Luke 23:43, “Truly I say to you, today you shall be with Me in Paradise.” Some other verses that theologians cite are Hebrews 12:23 and Philippians 1:23.

Most Christians have thought that the doctrine of an intermediate state is taught by scripture. Occasionally, some thinkers have proposed the doctrine of soul sleep which is incompatible with the doctrine of an intermediate state. The doctrine of soul sleep is the claim that when a person dies he or she is unconscious until he or she is resurrected. This contradicts the doctrine of an intermediate state because the doctrine of an intermediate state holds that the believer is aware and mentally active during the time between death and the receiving of the resurrection body.

The philosophical upshot of the doctrine of an intermediate state is that some philosophers think that it entails mind-body dualism. This is one of the major arguments of John W. Cooper’s Body, Soul & Life Everlasting. In the book he argues that there are only three options given in the New Testament. The first is the view that there is an intermediate state (which according to Cooper implies dualism). The second is the view that resurrection does not happen at any future time and thus when it does happen (say outside our normal dimension of time) it is “instantaneous.” Finally, the third view is that of a resurrection after a passage of time here on earth.

Cooper accepts the theological arguments for the claim that there is an intermediate state. Why does he think that an intermediate state entails dualism? It seems to be because he thinks that an intermediate state is necessarily a disembodied state and thus is, by definition, one in which the person exists and is a non-physical entity. If this is the case then mind-body dualism does follow. However, not all scholars accept his contention that a person existing in an intermediate state is disembodied. For example, Baker claims “there is no reason to suppose that the intermediate state (if there is one) is one of disembodiment” (Baker, 1995, p. 498). Cooper, of course, would reject this claim. The reasons he cites mirror the claims made by the proponent of the incompatibility of materialism and CDR. In short, Cooper thinks that there is no coherent way for a material object to be resurrected which is numerically identical to one that previously existed, whether this resurrection occurs in an intermediate state or at the general resurrection.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Baker, L.R. “Need a Christian be a Mind/Body Dualist?” Faith and Philosophy 12 (1995): 489-504.
    • An article which presents the constitution view of persons and which argues that constitutionalism is compatible with the doctrine of the resurrection of the dead.
  • Baker, L.R. Persons and Bodies. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
    • A major work in defense of constitutionalism.
  • Baker, L.R. “Persons and the metaphysics of resurrection.” Religious Studies, 43 (2007): 333–48.
    • An article which defends the constitution view of resurrection and touches on many of the other views discussed in this entry.
  • Bynum, C.W. The Resurrection of the Body in Western Christianity, 200-1336. New York: Columbia University Press, 1995.
    • A study of the doctrine of the resurrection of the dead in the early and medieval church.
  • Cooper, J.W. Body, Soul, & Life Everlasting. Grand Rapids Michigan: Eerdmans Publishing Company, 1989.
    • A book that argues for mind-body dualism based on the doctrine of the intermediate state. It includes a detailed study of the Old and New Testament accounts of the mind-body distinction and the doctrine of the resurrection.
  • Copleston, F. A History of Philosophy, Volume II: Medieval Philosophy. New York: Doubleday, 1993.
    • A good historical overview of medieval philosophy which includes details about Augustine, Bonaventure, and Aquinas and their views on resurrection and the relationship between the body and the soul.
  • Corcoran, Kevin J. “Persons and Bodies.” Faith and Philosophy 15 (1998): 324-340.
    • An article that combines constitutionalism and the falling elevator model.
  • Craig, W. L. The Son Rises: The Historical Evidence for the Resurrection of Jesus. Chicago: Moody, 1981.
    • An apologetic work in favor of the thesis that Jesus rose from the dead.
  • Grudem, W. Systematic Theology: An Introduction to Biblical Doctrine. Grand Rapids Michigan: Zondervan Publishing House, 1994. 810-839, 1109-1139.
    • A well organized systematic theology that contains references to many different religious traditions and creeds. Grudem is a conservative theologian and gives a clear, if not exhaustive, argument for traditional doctrines.
  • Habermans, G., Flew, A., and Miethe, T. Did Jesus Rise From the Dead? The Resurrection Debate. New York: Harper and Row, 1987.
    • Perspectives on whether or not Jesus did rise from the dead for a non-technical reader.
  • Hasker, W. “Emergentism.” Religious Studies 18 (1982): 473-488.
    • A defense of emergentism. Additionally, Hasker argues that the doctrine of resurrection makes dualism more attractive than materialism.
  • Hick, J. Philosophy of Religion. Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey: Prentice-Hall, 1973. 97-117.
    • Arguably, Hick argues for the replica model of resurrection. Additionally, there is a chapter on non-Christian accounts of life after death.
  • Hudson, H. A Materialist Metaphysics of the Human Person. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2001.
    • A defense of perdurantism and the falling elevator model of resurrection.
  • Leslie, John. Immortality Defended. Malden, Massachusetts: Blackwell publishing, 2007.
    • A book that defends a theistic (not Christian) view of resurrection that is notable for its use of modern physics and incorporation of eastern philosophy.
  • Merricks, T. “There are No Criteria of Identity Over Time.” Noûs 32 (1998): 106-124.
    • A technical defense of anti-criterialism.
  • Merricks, T. “The Resurrection of the Body and the Life Everlasting.” Reason for the Hope Within, ed. Michael Murray. Grand Rapids, Michigan: Eerdmans Publishing Company, 1999. 261-286.
    • A discussion of different accounts of resurrection and an argument for the claim that the doctrine of the resurrection provides support for materialism.
  • Perry, J. A Dialogue on Personal Identity and Immortality. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1978.
    • A good introduction to the philosophical problems surrounding resurrection. Written in dialogue form.
  • Plato, Phaedo. Translated by G.M.A Grube. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1977.
    • A fine translation of Plato’s work on the immortality of the soul.
  • Swinburne, R. The Evolution of the Soul. New York: Oxford, 1986.
    • A defense of Cartesian dualism that has a chapter on the future of the soul.
  • Van Inwagen, P. “The Possibility of Resurrection.” The Possibility of Resurrection and Other Essays in Christian Apologetics. Boulder, Colorado: Westview Press, 1998. 45-52.
    • A reprint of van Inwagen’s older article which defends the simulacra view. This version contains a significant postscript.
  • Zimmerman, D. “The Compatibility of Materialism and Survival: The ‘Falling Elevator’ Model.” Faith and Philosophy 16 (1999): 194-212.
    • The origins of the falling elevator model of resurrection.
  • Zimmerman, D. “Criteria of Identity and the ‘Identity Mystics’.” Erkenntnis 48 (1998): 281-301.
    • A discussion of criterialism.

Author Information

Jeff Green
Email: jgreen@hbu.edu
Houston Baptist University
U. S. A.

Game Theory

This article sketches the basic concepts of the theory of games in order to discuss some of their philosophical implications and problems.

Consider the following situation: when two hunters set out to hunt a stag and lose track of each other in the process, each hunter has to make a decision. Either she continues according to plan, hoping that her partner does likewise (because she cannot bag a deer on her own), and together they catch the deer; or she goes for a hare instead, securing a prey that does not require her partner’s cooperation, and thus abandoning the common plan. Each hunter prefers a deer shared between them to a hare for herself alone. But if she decides to hunt for deer, she faces the possibility that her partner abandons her, leaving her without deer or hare. So, what should she do? And, what will she do?

Situations like this, in which the outcome of an agent’s action depends on the actions of all the other agents involved, are called interactive. Two people playing chess is the archetypical example of an interactive situation, but so are elections, wage bargaining, market transactions, the arms race, international negotiations, and many more. Game theory studies these interactive situations. Its fundamental idea is that an agent in an interactive decision should and does take into account the deliberations of her opponents, who, in turn, take into account her deliberations. A rational agent in an interactive situation should therefore not ask: “What can I do, given what is likely to happen?” but rather: “What can I do in response to what they do, given that they have a belief about what I will do?” Based on this perspective, game theory recommends rational choices for these situations, and predicts agents’ behavior in them.

This article presents the basic tenets of game theory in a non-formal way. It then discusses two broad philosophical issues arising from the theory. First, whether the rationality concept employed by the theory is justifiable – whether it is intuitively rational to choose as the theory prescribes. Second, whether the theory can in principle be a good predictive theory of human behavior – whether it has empirical content, whether it is testable and whether there are good reasons to believe that it is true or false.

Table of Contents

  1. Sketch of the Theory
    1. Static Games
    2. Dynamic Games
    3. The Architecture of Game Theory
  2. Game Theory as a Theory of Rationality
    1. Sufficient Epistemic Conditions for Solution Concepts
    2. Nash Equilibrium in One-Shot Games
    3. Nash Equilibrium in Repeated Games
    4. Backward Induction
    5. Paradoxes of Rationality
    6. Bounded Rationality in Game Players
  3. Game Theory as a Predictive Theory
    1. The Evolutive Interpretation
    2. The Problem of Alternative Descriptions
    3. Testing Game Theory
  4. Conclusion
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Sketch of the Theory

Game theory belongs to a family of theories often subsumed under the umbrella term Rational Choice Theory. All these theories (in particular, decision theory, game theory and social choice theory) discuss conditions under which agents’ actions, or at least their decision to act, can be said to be rational. Depending on how these conditions are interpreted, Rational Choice theory may have a positive or a normative function: it may contribute to the prediction and explanation of agent behavior, or it may contribute to advising agents what they should do. Many of the purported functions of Rational Choice theory are controversial; as a part of it, game theory is affected by these controversies, in particular its usefulness for the social sciences. I will address some of these general issues in Section 3. However, game theory faces its own philosophical problems, and these will be the focus of this article.

Decision theory, as well as game theory, assesses the rationality of decisions in the light of preferences over outcomes and beliefs about the likelihood of these outcomes to appear. The basic difference between the two lies in the way they view the likelihood of outcomes. Decision theory treats all outcomes as exogenous events, ‘moves of nature’. Game theory, in contrast, focuses on those situations in which outcomes are determined by interactions of deliberating agents. It proposes that agents take outcomes as determined by other agents’ reasoning, and that agent therefore assess the likelihood of an outcome by trying to figure out how the other agents they interact with will reason. The likelihoods of outcomes therefore becomes “endogenous” in the sense that players take their opponents’ payoffs and rationality into account when figuring out the consequences of their strategies.

We are familiar with such reasoning from card and board games. When playing poker or chess, one must take one’s opponent’s reasoning into account in order to be successful. The player who foresees her opponent’s optimal reaction to her own move will be much more successful that the player who simply assumes that her opponent will make a certain move with a certain probability. Theoretical reflection about such parlor games are at the basis of game theory – for example, James Waldegrave’s discussion of the French card game Le Her in 1713, or von Neumann’s treatment ‘Zur Theorie der Gesellschaftsspiele’ (‘Towards a Theory of Parlor Games’) from 1928 – but today game theory has little to do with these games, and instead discusses a wide variety of social interactions. (Game theory is also applied to problems in biology and even in logic – these applications will not be discussed in this article).

The formal theory defines a game as consisting of two or more players, a set of pure strategies for each player and the players’ payoff functions. A player’s pure strategy specifies her choice for each time she has to choose in the game (which may be more than once). Players have to have at least two strategies to choose between, otherwise the game would be trivial. All players of a game together determine a consequence. Each chooses a specific strategy, and their combination (called strategy profiles) yields a specific consequence. The consequence of a strategy profile can be a material prize – for example money – but it can also be any other relevant event, like being the winner, or feeling guilt. Game theory is really only interested in the players’ evaluations of this consequence, which are specified in each players’ so-called payoff or utility function.

The part of the theory that deals with situations in which players’ choice of strategies cannot be enforced is called the theory of non-cooperative games. Cooperative game theory, in contrast, allows for pre-play agreements to be made binding (e.g. through legally enforceable contracts). This article will not discuss cooperative game theory. More specifically, it will focus – for reasons of simplicity – on non-cooperative games with two players, finite strategy sets and precisely known payoff functions.

Game theory uses two means to represent games formally: strategic form and extensive form. Commonly (though not necessarily!), these two methods of representation are associated with two different kinds of games. Extensive form games represent dynamic games, where players choose their actions in a determined temporal order. Strategic form games represent static games, where players choose their actions simultaneously.

a. Static Games

Static two-person games can be represented by m-by-n matrices, with m rows and n columns corresponding to the players’ strategies, and the entries in the squares representing the payoffs for each player for the pair of strategies (row, column) determining the square in question. As an example, figure 1 is a possible representation of the stag-hunt scenario described in the introduction.

Col’s Choice
C1 C2
Row’s
Choice
R1 2,2 0,1
R2 1,0 1,1

Figure 1: The stag hunt

The 2-by-2 matrix of figure 1 determines two players, Row and Col, who each have two pure strategies: R1 and C1 (go deer hunting) and R2 and C2 (go hare hunting). Combining the players’ respective strategies yields four different pure strategy profiles, each associated with a consequence relevant for both players: (R1,C1) leads to them catching a deer, (R2,C1) leaves Row with a hare and Col with nothing, (R2,C2) gets each a hare and (R1,C2) leaves Row empty-handed and Col with a hare. Both players evaluate these consequences of each profile. Put informally, players rank consequences as ‘better than’ or ‘equally good as’. In the stag-hunt scenario, players have the following ranking:

Row Col
1. (R1,C1)

2. (R2,C1); (R2,C2)

3. (R1,C2)

1. (R1,C1)

2. (R1,C2); (R2,C2)

3. (R2,C1)

Figure 2: The hunters’ respective rankings of the strategy profiles

This ranking can be quite simply represented by a numerical function u, according to the following two principles:

  1. For all consequences X, Y: X is better than Y if and only if u(X) > u(Y)
  2. For all consequences X, Y: X is equally good as Y if and only if u(X) = u(Y)

A function that meets these two principles (and some further requirements that are not relevant here) is called an ordinal utility function. Utility functions are used to represent players’ evaluations of consequences in games (for more on preferences and utility functions, see Grüne-Yanoff and Hansson 2006). Convention has it that the first number represents Row’s evaluation, while the second number represents Col’s evaluation. It is now easy to see that the numbers of the game in figure 1 represent the ranking of figure 2.

Note, however, that the matrix of figure 1 is not the only way to represent the stag-hunt game. Because the utilities only represent rankings, there are many ways how one can represent the ranking of figure 2. For example, the games in figures 3a-c are identical to the game in figure 1.

C1 C2
R1 -5,-5 -7,-6
R2 -6,-7 -6,-6

Figure 3a: 3rd version of the stag hunt

C1 C2
R1 100,100 1,99
R2 99,1 99,99

Figure 3b: 2nd version of the stag hunt

C1 C2
R1 -5,100 -7,-99
R2 -6,1 -6,99

Figure 3c: 1st version of the stag hunt

In figure 3a, all numbers are negative, but they retain the same ranking of consequences. And similarly in figure 3b, only that here the proportional relations between the numbers (which don’t matter) are different. This should also make clear that utility numbers only express a ranking for one and the same player, and do not allow to compare different players’ evaluations. In figure 3c, although the numbers are very different for the two players, they retain the same ranking as in figure 1. Comparing, say, Row’s evaluation of (R1,C1) with Col’s evaluation of (R1,C1) simply does not have any meaning.

Note that in the stag-hunt game, agents do not gain if others lose. Everybody is better off hunting deer, and losses arise from lack of coordination. Games with this property are therefore called coordination games. They stand in stark contrast to games in which one player’s gain is the other player’s loss. Most social games are of this sort: in chess, for example, the idea of coordination is wholly misplaced. Such games are called zero-sum games. They were the first games to be treated theoretically, and the pioneering work of game theory, von Neumann and Morgenstern’s (1944) The Theory of Games and Economic Behavior concentrates solely on them. Today, many of the games discussed are of a third kind: they combine coordination aspects with conflicting aspects, so that players may at times gain from coordinating, but at other times from competing with the other players. A famous example of such a game is the Prisoners’ Dilemma, to be discussed shortly.

Players can create further strategies by randomizing over pure strategies. They can choose a randomization device (like a dice) and determine for each chance result which of their pure strategies they will play. The resultant probability distribution over pure strategies is called a mixed strategy σ. For example, Row could create a new strategy that goes as follows: toss a (fair) coin. Play R1 if heads, and R2 if tails. Because a fair coin lands heads 50% of the time, such a mixed strategy is denoted σR = (0.5,0.5). As there are no limits to the number of possible randomization devices, each player can create an infinite number of mixed strategies for herself. The players’ evaluation of mixed strategies profiles is represented by the expected values of the corresponding pure-strategy payoffs. Such an expected value is computed as the weighted average of the pure-strategy payoffs, and the weights are the probabilities with which each strategy is played. For example, if Row in figure 1 plays her mixed strategy σR = (0.5,0.5), and Col plays a strategy σC = (0.8,0.2), then Row’s expected utility will be computed by:

uRRC) = 0.5(0.8×2 + 0.2×0) + 0.5(0.8×1 + 0.2×1) = 1.3

With the same mixed strategies, Col’s expected utility, uCRC) = 1. For the payoffs of mixed strategy to be computable, the utility function has to carry cardinal information. Now it is also important how much a player prefers a consequence X to a consequence Y, in comparison to another pair of consequences X and Z. Because mixed strategies are a very important concept in game theory, it is generally assumed that the utility functions characterizing the payoffs are cardinal. However, it is important to note that cardinal utilities also do not allow making interpersonal comparisons. In fact, such interpersonal comparisons play no role in standard game theory at all.

Solution Concepts

Representing interactive situations in these highly abstract games, the objective of game theory is to determine the outcome or possible outcomes of each game, given certain assumptions about the players. To do this is to solve a game. Various solution concepts have been proposed. The conceptually most straightforward solution concept is the elimination of dominated strategies. Take the game of figure 4 (which, take note, differs from the stag-hunt game in its payoffs). In this game, no matter what Col chooses, playing R2 gives Row a higher payoff. If Col plays C1, Row is better off playing R2, because she can obtain 3 utils instead of two. If Col plays C2, Row is also better off playing R2, because she can obtain 1 utils instead of none. Similarly for Col: no matter what Row chooses, playing C2 gives her a higher payoff. This is what is meant by saying that R1 and C1 are strictly dominated strategies.

C1 C2
R1
2,2
0,3
R2
3,0
1,1

Figure 4: The Prisoners’ Dilemma

More generally, a player A’s pure strategy is strictly dominated if there exists another (pure or mixed) strategy for A that has a higher payoff for each of A’s opponent’s strategies. To solve a game by eliminating all dominated strategies is based on the assumption that players do and should choose those strategies that are best for them, in this very straightforward sense. In cases like in figure 4, where each player has only one non-dominated strategy, the elimination of dominated strategies is a straightforward and plausible solution concept. However, there are many games, which do not have any dominated strategies, as for example the stag-hunt game or the zero-sum game of figure 5.

Recall that in a zero sum game, one player’s payoff is exactly the inverse of that of the other player. For example, figure 5 shows Row’s payoffs, while Col’s payoffs are the negative of Row’s payoffs.

C1 C2 C3
R1 1 3 6
R2 7 5 5
R3 3 4 10

Figure 5: A zero-sum game

Von Neumann and Morgenstern argued for the Minimax Rule as the solution concept for zero-sum games. In these games, they suggest, each player makes the following consideration: ‘my adversary tries to get out of the play as much as possible. Her gain is my loss. So I better look for how much I minimally get out of each option and try to make this amount as large as possible. If this is reasonable, then my adversary will do the same. Since my maximizing my minimum is best against her maximizing her minimum, I should stick to my choice’. The minimax solution therefore recommends that Row choose the strategy with the highest minimum, while Col choose a strategy with the lowest maximum. Thus, in figure 5, Row chooses R2, as it has the highest minimal payoff for her, and Col chooses C2, as it has the lowest maximal payoff for Row (and hence the highest minimal payoff for her).

Unfortunately, there are many non-zero-sum games without dominated strategies, for example the game of figure 6.

C1 C2 C3
R1 3,4 2,5 1,3
R2 4,8 1,2 0,9

Figure 6: A game without dominated strategies

For these kinds of games, the Nash equilibrium solution concept offers greater versatility than dominance or maximin (as it turns out, all maximin solutions are also Nash equilibria). In contrast to dominated strategy elimination, the Nash equilibrium applies to strategy profiles, not to individual strategies. Roughly, a strategy profile is in Nash equilibrium if none of the players can do better by unilaterally changing her strategy. Take the example of matrix 6. Consider the strategy profile (R1,C1). If Row knew that Col would play C1, then she would play R2 because that’s the best she can do against C1. On the other hand, if Col knew that Row would play R1, he would play C2 because that’s the best he can do against R1. So (R1, C1) is not in equilibrium, because at least one player (in this case both) is better off by unilaterally deviating from it. Similarly for (R1, C3), (R2, C1), (R2,C2) and (R2, C3): in all these profiles, one of the players can improve her or his lot by deviating from the profile. Only (R1, C2) is a pure strategy Nash equilibrium – neither player is better off by unilaterally deviating from it.

There are games without a pure strategy Nash equilibrium, as matrix 7 shows. The reader can easily verify that each player has an incentive to deviate, whichever pure strategy the other chooses.

C1 C2
R1 1,-1 -1,1
R2 -1,1 1,-1

Figure 7: Matching pennies

However, there is an equilibrium involving mixed strategies. Randomizing between the two strategies, assigning equal probability to each, yields a payoff of 0.5(0.5×1+0.5x-1)+0.5(0.5×1+0.5x-1) = 0 for both players. As mutually best responses, these mixed strategies constitute a Nash equilibrium. As one of the fundamental results of game theory, it has been shown that every finite static game has a mixed-strategy equilibrium (Nash 1950). Many games have several Nash equilibria. Take for example figure 1. There, neither player has an incentive to deviate from (R1, C1), nor to deviate from (R2, C2). Thus both strategy profiles are pure-strategy Nash equilibria. With two or more possible outcomes, the equilibrium concept loses much of its appeal. It no longer gives an obvious answer to the normative, explanatory or predictive questions game theory sets out to answer. The assumption that one specific Nash equilibrium is played relies on there being some mechanism or process that leads all the players to expect the same equilibrium.

Schelling’s (1960) theory of focal points suggests that in some “real-life” situations players may be able to coordinate on a particular equilibrium by using information that is abstracted away by the strategic form. Examples of information that has such focal power may be the names of strategies or past common experiences of the players. Little systematic work exists on the “focalness” of various strategies, as they depend on the players’ cultural and personal backgrounds. Mainstream game theory has never incorporated these concepts into the formal structure of the theory (for exceptions, see Bacharach 1993, Sugden 1995).

A focal point that might evade such context-dependence is Pareto-dominance, if pre-play communication is allowed. An equilibrium is Pareto-dominant over another if it makes everybody at least as well off and makes at least one person better off. This is the case in the game of figure 1: (R1, C1) makes both players better off than (R2, C2). The intuition for this focal point is that, even though the players cannot commit themselves to play the way they claim they will, the pre-play communication lets the players reassure one another about the low risk of playing the strategy of the Pareto-dominant equilibrium. Although pre-play communication may make the Pareto-dominant equilibrium more likely in the stag-hunt game, it is not clear that it does so in general. Many other selection mechanisms have been proposed that use clues derivable from the game model alone. These mechanisms are however too complex to be discussed here.

As it will become clearer in Section 2b, the assumptions underlying the application of the Nash concept are somewhat problematic. The most important alternative solution concept is that of rationalizability, which is based on weaker assumptions. Instead of relying on the equilibrium concept, rationalizability selects strategies that are “best” from the players’ subjective point of view. Players assign a subjective probability to each of the possible strategies of their opponents, instead of postulating their opponents’ choices and then finding a best response to it, as in the Nash procedure. Further, knowing their opponent’s payoffs, and knowing they are rational, players expect others to use only strategies that are best responses to some belief they might have about themselves. And those beliefs in turn are informed by the same argument, leading to an infinite regress of the form: “I’m playing strategy σ1 because I think player 2 is using σ2, which is a reasonable belief because I would play it if I were player 2 and I thought player 1 was using σ1’, which is a reasonable thing for player 2 to expect because σ1’ is a best response to σ2’…”. A strategy is rationalizable for a player if it survives infinitely repeated selections as a best response to some rational belief she might have about the strategies of her opponent. A strategy profile is rationalizable if the strategies contained in it are rationalizable for each player. It has been shown that every Nash equilibrium is rationalizable. Further, the set of rationalizable strategies is nonempty and contains at least one pure strategy for each player (Bernheim 1984, Pearce 1984). The problem with rationalizability is thus not its applicability; rather, there are too many rationalizable strategies, so that the application of rationalizability often does not provide a clear answer to the advisory and predictive questions posed to game theory.

b. Dynamic Games

In static games discussed above, players choose their actions simultaneously. Many interactive situations, however, are dynamic: a player chooses before others do, knowing that the others choices will be influenced by his observable choice. Players who choose later will make their choices dependent on their knowledge of how others have chosen. Chess is a typical example of such a dynamic interactive situation (although one, as will be seen, that is far too complex to explicitly model it). Game theory commonly represents these dynamic situations in extensive form. This representation makes explicit the order in which players move, and what each player knows when making each of his decisions.

The extensive form consists of six elements. First, the set of players is determined. Each player is indexed with a number, starting with 1. Second, it is determined who moves when. The order of moves is captured in a game tree, as illustrated in figure 8. A tree is a finite collection of ordered nodes x (This index is for instructive purposes only. Commonly, nodes are only indexed with the number of the player choosing at this node). Each tree starts with one (and only one!) initial node, and grows only ‘down’ and never ‘up’ from there. The nodes that are not predecessors to any others are called terminal nodes, denoted z1-z4 in figure 8. All nodes but the terminal ones are labeled with the number of that player who chooses at this node. Each z describes a complete and unique path through the tree from the initial to one final node.

Figure 8: A game tree

Third, the payoffs for all players are assigned (as an list of utility numbers: first player’s utility in the first place, etc.) to the terminal nodes. An illustration is given in figure 8. The utility functions of each player have to satisfy the same requirements as those in static games. Fourth, for each player at each node, a finite set of actions is specified, labeled with capital letters in figure 8. Each action leads to one (and only one) non-initial node. Fifth, it is determined what each player knows about her position in the game when she makes her choice. Her knowledge is represented by a partition of the nodes of the tree, called the information set. If the information set contains, say, nodes x and x’, this means that the player who is choosing an action at x is uncertain whether she is at x or at x’. To avoid inconsistencies, information sets can contain only nodes at which the same player chooses, and only nodes where the same player has the same actions to choose from. In figure 9, an information set containing more than one node is represented as a dotted line between those nodes (Information sets that contain only one node are usually not represented). Games that contain only singleton information sets are called games of perfect information: all agents know where they are at all nodes of the game. Further, it is commonly assumed that agents have perfect recall: they neither forget what they once knew, nor what they have chosen.

Figure 9: A game of imperfect information

Sixth and last, when a game involves chance moves, the probabilities are displayed in brackets, as in the game of figure 10. There, a chance move (by an imagined player called N like “Nature’) determines the payoffs for both players. Player 1 then plays L or R. Player 2 observes player 1’s action, but does not know whether he is at x or x’ (if player 1 chose L) nor whether he is at y or y’ (if player 1 chose R). In other words, player 2 faces a player whose payoffs he does not know. All he knows is that player 1 can be either of two types, distinguished by the respective utility function.

Figure 10: A game of incomplete information

Games such as that in figure 10 will not be further discussed in this article. They are games of incomplete information, where players do not know their and other players’ payoffs, but only have probability distributions over them.

Extensive-form games can be represented as strategic-form games. While in extensive-form interpretation, the players “wait” until their respective information set is reached to make a decision, in the strategic-form interpretation they make a complete contingency plan in advance. Figure 11 illustrates this transformation. Player 1, who becomes “Row’, has only two strategies to choose from. Player 2, who becomes “Col’, has to decide in advance for both the case where player 1 chooses U and where she chooses D. His strategies thus contain two moves each: for example, (L,R) means that he plays L after U and R after D.

Figure 11: Extensive form reduced to strategic form

A similar terminology as in strategic-form games applies. A pure strategy for a player determines her choice at each of her information sets (That is, a strategy specifies all the past and future moves of an agent. Seen from this perspective, one may legitimately doubt whether extensive games really capture the dynamics of interaction to any interesting extent). A behavior strategy specifies a probability distribution over actions at each information set. For games of perfect recall, behavior strategies are equivalent to mixed strategies known from strategic-form games (Kuhn 1953).

Solution Concepts

Given that the strategic form can be used to represent arbitrarily complex extensive-form games, the Nash equilibrium can also be applied as a solution concept to extensive form games. However, the extensive form provides more information than the strategic form, and on the basis of that extra information, it is sometimes possible to separate the “reasonable” from the “unreasonable” Nash equilibria. Take the example from figure 11. The game has three Nash equilibria, which can be identified in the game matrix: (U, (L,L)); (D, (L,R)) and (D, (R,R)). But the first and the third equilibria are suspect, when one looks at the extensive form of the game. After all, if player 2’s right information set was reached, the he should play R (given that R gives him 3 utils while L gives him only –1 utils). But if player 2’s left information set was reached, then he should play L (given that L gives him 2 utils, while R gives him only 0 utils). Moreover, player 1 should expect player 2 to choose this way, and hence she should choose D (given that her choosing D and player 2 choosing R gives her 2 utils, while her choosing U and player 2 choosing L gives her only 1 util). The equilibria (U, (L,L)) and (D, (R,R)) are not “credible’, because they rely on an “empty threat” by player 2. The threat is empty because player 2 would never wish to carry out either of them. The Nash equilibrium concept neglects this sort of information, because it is insensitive to what happens off the path of play.

To identify “reasonable” Nash equilibria, game theorists have employed equilibrium refinements. The simplest of these is the backward-induction solution that applies to finite games of perfect information. Its rational was already used in the preceding paragraph. “Zermelo’s algorithm” (Zermelo 1913) specifies its procedure more exactly: Since the game is finite, it has a set of penultimate nodes – i.e. nodes whose immediate successors are terminal nodes. Specify that the player, who can move at each such node, chooses whichever action that leads to the successive terminal node with the highest payoff for him (in case of a tie, make an arbitrary selection). So in the game of figure 11, player 2’s choices R if player 1 chooses U and L if player 1 chooses D can be eliminated:

Figure 11a: First step of backward induction

Now specify that each player at those nodes, whose immediate successors are penultimate nodes, choose the action that maximizes her payoff over the feasible successors, given that the players at the penultimate nodes play as we have just specified. So now player 1’s choice U can be eliminated:

Figure 11b: Second step of backward induction

Then roll back through the tree, specifying actions at each node (not necessary for the given example anymore, but one gets the point). Once done, one will have specified a strategy for each player, and it is easy to check that these strategies form a Nash equilibrium. Thus, each finite game of perfect information has a pure-strategy Nash equilibrium.

Backward induction fails in games with imperfect information. In a game like in figure 12, there is no way to specify an optimal choice for player 2 in his second information set, without first specifying player 2’s belief about the previous choice of player 1. Zermelo’s algorithm is inapplicable because it presumes that such an optimal choice exists at every information set given a specification of play at its successors.

Figure 12: A game not solvable by backward induction

However, if one accepts the argument for backward induction, the following is also convincing. The game beginning at player 1’s second information set is a simultaneous-move game identical to the one presented in figure 7. The only Nash equilibrium of this game is a mixed strategy with a payoff of 0 for both players (as argued in Section 1a). Using the equilibrium payoff as player 2’s payoff to choose R, it is obvious that player 2 maximizes his payoff by choosing L, and that player 1 maximizes her payoff by choosing R. More generally, an extensive form game can be analyzed into proper subgames, each of which satisfies the definition of extensive-form games in their own right. Games of imperfect information can thus be solved by replacing a proper subgame with one of its Nash equilibrium payoffs (if necessary repeatedly), and performing backward induction on the reduced tree. This equilibrium refinement technique is called subgame perfection.

Repeated Games

Repeated games are a special kind of dynamic game. They proceed in temporal stages, and players can observe all players’ play of these previous stages. At the end of each stage, however, the same structure repeats itself. Let’s recall the static game of figure 4. As discussed in the previous section, it can be equivalently represented as an extensive game where player 2 does not know at which node he is.

Figure 13: Equivalent Static and Extensive Games

All that changed from the original game from figure 4 is the nomination of the players (Row becomes 1 and Col becomes 2) and the strategies (C and D). A repetition of this game is shown in figure 14. Instead of the payoff matrices, at each of terminal nodes of the original static game, the same game starts again. The payoffs accumulate over this repetition: while in the static game, the strategy profile (D,D) yields (1,1), the strategy profile ((D,D),(D,D)) in figure 14 yields (2,2). These payoffs are written at the terminal nodes of the last repetition game.

Figure 14: A repeated Prisoners’ Dilemma

If a repeated game ends after a finite number of stages, it is solved by subgame perfection. Starting with the final subgames, the Nash equilibrium in each is (D,D). Because the payoffs are accumulative, the preference structure within each subgame does not change (recall from Section 1a that only ordinal information is needed here). Thus for each subgame at any stage of the repetition, the Nash equilibrium will be (D,D). Therefore, for any number of finite repetitions of the game from figure 4, subgame perfection advises both players to always play D.

All this changes dramatically, if the game is repeated indefinitely. The first thing that needs reinterpretation are the payoffs. Any positive payoff, whether large or small, would be infinitely large if they just summed up over indefinitely many rounds. This would obliterate any interesting concept of an indefinitely repeated game. Fortunately, there is an intuitive solution: people tend to value present benefits higher than those in the distant future. In other words, they discount the value of future consequences by the distance in time by which these consequences occur. Hence in indefinitely repeated games, players’ payoffs are specified as the discounted sum of what each player wins at each stage.

The second thing that changes with indefinitely repeated game is that the solution concept of subgame perfection does not apply, because there is no final subgame at which the solution concept could start. Instead, the players may reason as follows. Player 1 may tell player 2 that she is well disposed towards him, relies on his honesty, and will trust him (i.e. play C) until proven wrong. Once he proves to be untrustworthy, she will distrust him (i.e. play D) forever. In the infinitely repeated game, player 2 has no incentive to abuse her trust if he believes her declaration. If he did, he would make a momentary gain from playing D while his opponent plays C. This would be followed, however, by him forever forgoing the extra benefit from (C,C) in comparison to (D,D). Unless player 2 has a very high discount rate, the values the present gain from cheating will be offset by the future losses from non-cooperating. More generally, the folk theorem shows that in infinitely repeated games with low enough discounting of the future, any strategy that give each player more than the worst payoff the others can force him to take is sustainable as an equilibrium (Fudenberg and Maskin 1986). It is noteworthy that for the folk theorem to apply, it is sufficient that players do not know when a repeated game ends, and have a positive belief that it may go on forever. It is more appropriate to speak of indefinitely repeated games, than of infinitely repeated ones, as the former does not conflict with the intuition that humans cannot interact infinitely many times.

c. The Architecture of Game Theory

From a philosophy of science perspectives, game theory has an interesting structure. Like many other theories, it employs highly abstract models, and it seeks to explain, to predict and to advice on phenomena of the real world by a theory that operates through these abstract models. What is special about game theory, however, is that this theory does not provide a general and unified mode of dealing with all kinds of phenomena, but rather offers a ‘toolbox’, from which the right tools must be selected.

As discussed in the two preceding sections, game theory consists of game forms (the matrices and trees), and a set of propositions (the ‘theory proper’) that defines what a game form is and provides solution concepts that solve these models. Game theorists often focus on the development of the formal apparatus of the theory proper. Their interest lies in proposing alternative equilibrium concepts or proving existing results with fewer assumptions, not in representing and solving particular interactive situations. “Game theory is for proving theorems, not for playing games” (Reinhard Selten, quoted in Goeree and Holt 2001, 1419).

Although they habitually employ labels like ‘players’, ‘strategies’ or ‘payoffs’, the game forms that the theory proper defines and helps solving are really only abstract mathematical objects, without any link to the real world. After all, only very few social situations come with labels like ‘strategies’ or ‘rules of the game’ attached. What is needed instead is an interpretation of a real-world situation in terms of the formal elements provided by the theory proper, so that it can be represented by a game form. In many cases, this is where all the hard work lies: to construct a game form that captures the relevant aspects of a real social phenomenon. To acquire an interpretation, the game forms are complemented with an appropriate story (Morgan 2005) or model narrative. As regularly exemplified in textbooks, this narrative may be purely illustrative: it provides (in non-formal terms) a plausible account of an interactive situation, whose salient features can be represented by the formal tools of game theory. A good example of such a narrative is given by Selten when discussing the ‘Chain Store Paradox’:

A chain store, also called player A, has branches in 20 towns, numbered from 1 to 20. In each of these towns there is a potential competitor, a small businessman who might raise money at the local bank in order to establish a second shop of the same kind. The potential competitor at town k is called player k. […]
Just now none of the 20 small businessmen has enough owned capital to be able to get a sufficient credit from the local bank but as time goes on, one after the other will have saved enough to increase his owned capital to the required amount. This will happen first to player 1, then to player 2, etc. As soon as this time comes for player k, he must decide whether he wants to establish a second shop in his town or whether he wants to use his owned capital in a different way. If he chooses the latter possibility, he stops being a potential competitor of player A. If a second shop is established in town k, then player A has to choose between two price policies for town k. His response may be ‘cooperative’ or ‘aggressive’. The cooperative response yields higher profits in town k, both for player A and for player k, but the profits of player A in town k are even higher if player k does not establish a second shop. Player k’s profits in case of an aggressive response are such that it is better for him not to establish a second shop if player A responds in this way. (Selten 1978, 127).

The narrative creates a specific, if fictional, context that is congruent with the structure of dynamic form games. The players are clearly identifiable, and the strategies open to them are specified. The story also determines the material outcomes of each strategy combination, and the players’ evaluation of these outcomes. The story complements a game form of the following sort:

Figure 15: One step in the Chain store’s paradox

Game form and model narrative together constitute a model of a possible real-world situation. The model narrative fulfills two crucial functions in the model. If the game form is given first, it interprets this abstract mathematical object as a possible situation; if a real-world phenomenon is given first, it accounts for the phenomenon in such a way that it can be represented by a game form, which in turn can be solved by the theory proper.

The architecture of game theory is summarized in figure 16:

Figure 16: The architecture of game theory (Grüne-Yanoff and Schweinzer 2008)

The theory proper (on the left hand side of Figure 16) specifies the concept of a game, it provides the mathematical elements that are needed for the construction of a game form, and it offers solution concepts for the thus constructed game forms. The game form (left half of the central circle) is constructed from elements of the theory proper. The model narrative (the right half of the central circle) provides an account of a real or hypothetical economic situation. Its account of the situation interprets the game form.

As discussed in the previous sections, however, a specified game form can be solved by different solution concepts. Sometimes, as in the case of minimax and Nash equilibrium for zero-sum games, the reasoning behind the solution concepts is different, but the result is always the same. In other cases, in particular when equilibrium refinements are applied, applying different solution concepts to the same game form yields different results. As will be seen in Section 2e, this is also the case with the chain-store paradox. The reason for this ambiguity is that the application of many solution concepts requires information that is not contained in the game form. Instead, the information needed is found in an appropriate account of the situation – i.e. in the model narrative. Thus the model narrative takes on a third crucial function in game theory: it supports the choice of the appropriate solution concept for a specific game (Grüne-Yanoff and Schweinzer 2008).

This observation about the architecture of game theory and the role of informal model narratives in it has two very important implications. First, it becomes clear that game theory does not offer a universal notion of rationality, but rather offers a menu of tools to model specific situations at varying degrees and kinds of rationality. Ultimately, it is the modeler who judges on her own intuitions which kind of rationality to attributed to the interacting agents in a given situation. This opens up the discussion about the various intuitions that lie behind the solution concepts, the possibility of mutually inconsistent intuitions, and the question whether a meta-theory can be constructed that unifies all these fragmentary intuitions. Some of these issues will be discussed in Section 2.

The second implication of this observation concerns the status of game theory as a positive theory. Given its multi-layer architecture, any disagreement of prediction and observation can be attributed to a mistake either in the theory, the game form or the model narrative. This then raises the question how to test game theory, and whether game theory is refutable in principle. These questions will be discussed in Section 3.

2. Game Theory as a Theory of Rationality

Game theory has often been interpreted as a part of a general theory of rational behavior. This interpretation was already in the minds of game theories’ founders, who wrote in their Theory of Games and Economic Behavior:

We wish to find the mathematically complete principles which define “rational behavior” for the participants in a social economy, and to derive from them the general characteristics of that behavior (von Neumann and Morgenstern 1944, 31).

To interpret game theory as a theory of rationality means to give it a prescriptive task: it recommends what agents should do in specific interactive situations, given their preferences. To evaluate the success of this rational interpretation of game theory means to investigate its justification, in particular the justification of the solution concepts it proposes. That human agents ought to behave in such and such a way of course does not mean that they will do so; hence there is little sense in testing rationality claims empirically. The rational interpretation of game theory therefore needs to be distinguished from the interpretation of game theory as a predictive and explanatory theory. The solution concepts are either justified by identifying sufficient conditions for them, and showing that these conditions are already accepted as justified; or they can be justified directly by compelling intuitive arguments.

a. Sufficient Epistemic Conditions for Solution Concepts

One way to investigate game theoretic rationality is to reduce its solution concepts to the more intuitively understood notion of rationality under uncertainty in decision theory. By clearly stating the decision theoretic conditions agents have to satisfy in order to choose in accordance with game theoretic solution concepts, we obtain a better understanding of what game theory requires, and are thus able to assess criticism against it more clearly.

Recall that the various solution concepts presented in Section 1 advise how to choose one’s action rationally when the outcome of one’s choice depends on the actions of the other players, who in turn base their choices on the expectation of how one will choose. The solution concepts thus not only require the players to choose according to maximization considerations; they also require the agent to maximize their expected utilities on the basis of certain beliefs. Most prominently, these beliefs include their expectations about what the other players expect of them, and their expectations what the other players will choose on the basis of these expectations. These conditions are often not made explicit when people discuss game theory; however, without fulfilling them, players cannot be expected to choose in accord with specific solution concepts. To make these conditions on the agent’s knowledge and beliefs explicit will thus further our understanding what is involved in the solution concepts. In addition, if these epistemic conditions turn out to be justifiable, one would have achieved progress in justifying the solution concepts themselves. This line of thought has in fact been so prominent that the interpretation of game theory as a theory of rationality has often been called the eductive or epistemic interpretation. In the following, the various solution concepts discussed with respect to their sufficient epistemic conditions, and the conditions are investigated with regard to their acceptability.

For the solution of eliminating dominated strategies, nothing is required beyond the rationality of the players and their knowledge of their own strategies and payoffs. Each player can rule out her dominated strategies on the basis of maximization considerations alone, without knowing anything about the other player. To the extent that maximization considerations are accepted, this solution concept is therefore justified.

The case is more complex for iterated elimination of dominated strategies (this solution concept was not explained before, so don’t be confused. It fits in most naturally here). In the game matrix of figure 17, only Row has a dominated strategy, R1. Eliminating R1 will not yield a unique solution. Iterated elimination allows players to consecutively eliminate dominated strategies. However, it requires stronger epistemic conditions.

C1 C2 C3
R1 3,2 1,3 1,1
R2 5,4 2,1 4,2
R3 4,3 3,2 2,4

Figure 17: A game allowing for iterated elimination of dominated strategies

If Col knows that Row will not play R1, she can eliminate C2 as a dominated strategy, given that R1was eliminated. But to know that, Col has to know:

  1. Row’s strategies and payoffs
  2. that Row knows her strategies and payoffs
  3. that Row is rational

Let’s assume that Col knows i.-iii., and that he thus expects Row to have spotted and eliminated R1 as a dominated strategy. Given that Row knows that Col did this, Row can now eliminate R3. But for her to know that Col eliminated C2, she has to know:

  1. Row’s (i.e. her own) strategies and payoffs
  2. that she, Row, is rational
  3. that Col knows i.-ii.
  4. Col’s strategies and payoffs
  5. that Col knows her strategies and payoffs
  6. that Col is rational

Lets look at the above epistemic conditions a bit more closely. i. is trivial, as she has to know her own strategies and payoffs even for simple elimination. For simple elimination, she also has to be rational, but she does not have to know it – hence ii. If Row knows i. and ii., she knows that she would eliminate R1. Similarly, if Col knows i. and ii., he knows that Row would eliminate R1. If Row knows that Col knows that she would eliminate R1, and if Row also knows iv.-vi., then she knows that Col would eliminate C2. In a similar fashion, if Col knows that Row knows i.-vi., she will know that Row would eliminate R3. Knowing this, he would eliminate C3, leaving (R2,C1) as the unique solution of the game.

Generally, iterated elimination of dominated strategy requires that each player knows the structure of the game, the rationality of the players and, most importantly, that she knows that the opponent knows that she knows this. The depth of one player knowing that the other knows, etc. must be at least as high as the number of iterated elimination necessary to arrive at a unique solution. Beyond that, no further “he knows that she knows that he knows…” is required. Depending on how long the chain of iterated eliminations becomes, the knowledge assumptions may become difficult to justify. In long chains, even small uncertainties in the players’ knowledge may thus put the justification of this solution concept in doubt.

From the discussion so far, two epistemic notions can be distinguished. If all players know a proposition p, one says that they have mutual knowledge of p. As the discussion of iterated elimination showed, mutual knowledge is too weak for some solution concepts. For example, condition iii insists that Row not only know her own strategies, but also knows that Col knows. In the limit, this chain of one player knowing that the other knows that p, that she knows that he knows that she knows that p, etc. is continued ad infinitum. In this case, one says that players have common knowledge of the proposition p. When discussing common knowledge, it is important to distinguish of what the players have common knowledge. Standardly, common knowledge is of the structure of the game and the rationality of the players. As figure 18 indictates, this form of common knowledge is sufficient for the players to adhere to solutions provide by rationalizability.

Solution Concept Structure of the Game Rationality Choices or Beliefs
Simple Elimination of Dominated Strategies Each player knows her payoffs Fact of rationality
Iterated Elimination of Dominated Strategies Knowledge of the degree of iteration Knowledge of the degree of iteration
Rationalizability Common knowledge Common knowledge
Pure-Strategy Nash Equilibrium Fact of rationality Mutual knowledge of choices
Mixed-Strategy Equilibrium in Two-Person Games Mutual knowledge Mutual knowledge Mutual knowledge of beliefs

Figure 18: Epistemic requirements for solution concepts (adapted from Brandenburger 1992)

As figure 18 further indicates, sufficient epistemic conditions for pure-strategy Nash equilibria are even more problematic. Common knowledge of the game structure or rationality is neither necessary nor sufficient, not even in conjunction with epistemic rationality. Instead, it is required that all players know what the others will choose (in the pure-strategy case) or what the others will conjecture all players will be choosing (in the mixed-strategy case). This is an implausibly strong requirement. Players commonly do not know how their opponents will play. If there is no argument how players can reliably obtain this knowledge from less demanding information (like payoffs, strategies, and common knowledge thereof) then the analysis of the epistemic conditions would put into doubt whether players will reach Nash equilibrium. Note, however, that these epistemic conditions are sufficient, not necessary. Formally, nobody has been able to establish alternative epistemic conditions that are sufficient. But by discussing alternative reasoning processes, some authors have at least provided arguments for the plausibility that player soften reach Nash equilibrium. Some of these arguments will be discussed in the next section. (For further discussion of epistemic conditions of solution concepts, see Bicchieri 1993, chapter 2).

b. Nash Equilibrium in One-Shot Games

The Nash equilibrium concept is often seen as “the embodiment of the idea that economic agents are rational; that they simultaneously act to maximize their utility” (Aumann 1985, 43). Particularly in the context of one-shot games, however, doubts remain about the justifiability of this particular concept of rationality. It seems reasonable to claim that once the players have arrived at an equilibrium pair, neither has any reason for changing his strategy choice unless the other player does too. But what reason is there to expect that they will arrive at one? Why should Row choose a best reply to the strategy chosen by Col, when Row does not know Col’s choice at the time she is choosing? In these questions, the notion of equilibrium becomes somewhat dubious: when scientists say that a physical system is in equilibrium, they mean that it is in a stable state, where all causal forces internal to the system balance each other out and so leave it “at rest” unless it is disturbed by some external force. That understanding cannot be applied to the Nash equilibrium, when the equilibrium state is to be reached by rational computation alone. In a non-metaphorical sense, rational computation simply does not involve causal forces that could balance each other out. When approached from the rational interpretation of game theory, the Nash equilibrium therefore requires a different understanding and justification. In this section, two interpretations and justifications of the Nash equilibrium are discussed.

Self-Enforcing Agreements

Often, the Nash equilibrium is interpreted as a self-enforcing agreement. This interpretation is based on situations in which agents can talk to each other, and form agreements as to how to play the game, prior to the beginning of the game, but where no enforcement mechanism providing independent incentives for compliance with agreements exists. Agreements are self-enforcing if each player has reasons to respect them in the absence of external enforcement.

It has been argued that self-enforcing agreement is neither necessary nor sufficient for Nash equilibrium. That it is not necessary is quite obvious in games with many Nash equilibria. For example, the argument for focal points, as discussed in Section 1a, states that only Nash equilibria that have some extra ‘focal’ quality are self-enforcing. It also has been argued that Nash equilibria are not sufficient. Risse (2000) argues that the notion of self-enforcing agreements should be understood as an agreement that provides some incentives for the agents to stick to it, even without external enforcement. He then goes on to argue that there are such self-enforcing agreements that are not Nash equilibria. Take for example the game in figure 19.

C1 C2
R1
0,0
4,2
R2
2,4
3,3

Figure 19

Lets imagine the players initially agreed to play (R2, C2). Now both have serious reasons to deviate, as deviating unilaterally would profit either player. Therefore, the Nash equilibria of this game are (R1,C2) and (R2,C1). However, in an additional step of reflection, both players may note that they risk ending up with nothing if they both deviate, particularly as the rational recommendation for each is to unilaterally deviate. Players may therefore prefer the relative security of sticking to the agreed-upon strategy. They can at least guarantee 2 utils for themselves, whatever the other player does, and this in combination with the fact that they agreed on (R2, C2) may reassure them that their opponent will in fact play strategy 2. So (R2, C2) may well be a self-enforcing agreement, but it nevertheless is not a Nash equilibrium.

Last, the argument from self-enforcing agreements does not account for mixed strategies. In mixed equilibria all strategies with positive probabilities are best replies to the opponent’s strategy. So once a player’s random mechanism has assigned an action to her, she might as well do something else. Even though the mixed strategies might have constituted a self-enforcing agreement before the mechanism made its assignment, it is hard to see what argument a player should have to stick to her agreement after the assignment is made (Luce ad Raiffa 1957, 75).

Simulation

Another argument for one-shot Nash equilibria commences from the idea that agents are sufficiently similar to take their own deliberations as simulations of their opponents’ deliberations.

“The most sweeping (and perhaps, historically, the most frequently invoked) case for Nash equilibrium…asserts that a player’s strategy must be a best response to those selected by other players, because he can deduce what those strategies are. Player i can figure out j’s strategic choice by merely imagining himself in j’s position. (Pearce 1984, 1030).

Jacobsen (1996) formalizes this idea with the help of three assumptions. First, he assumes that a player in a two-person game imagines himself in both positions of the game, choosing strategies and forming conjectures about the other player’s choices. Second, he assumes that the player behaves rationally in both positions. Thirdly, he assumes that a player conceives of his opponent as similar to himself; i.e. if he chooses a strategy for the opponent while simulating her deliberation, he would also choose that position if he was in her position. Jacobsen shows that on the basis of these assumptions, the player will choose his strategies so that it and his conjecture on the opponent’s play are a Nash equilibrium. If his opponent also holds such a Nash equilibrium conjecture (which she should, given the similarity assumption), then the game has a unique Nash equilibrium.

This argument has met at least two criticisms. First, Jacobsen provides an argument for Nash equilibrium conjectures, not Nash equilibria. If each player ends up with a multiplicity of Nash equilibrium conjectures, an additional coordination problem arises over and above the coordination of which Nash equilibrium to play: now first the conjectures have to be matched before the equilibria can be coordinated.

Secondly, when simulating his opponent, a player has to form conjectures about his own play from the opponent’s perspective. This requires that he predict his own behavior. However, Levi (1997) raises the objection that to deliberate excludes the possibility of predicting one’s own behavior. Otherwise deliberation would be vacuous, since the outcome is determined when the relevant parameters of the choice situation are available. Since game theory models players as deliberating between which strategies to choose, they cannot, if Levi’s argument is correct, also assume that players, when simulating others’ deliberation, predict their own choices.

Concluding this section, it seems that there is no general justification for Nash equilibria in one-shot, simultaneous-move games. This does not mean that there is no justification to apply the Nash concept to any one-shot, simultaneous-move game – for example, games solvable by iterated dominance have a Nash equilibrium as their solution. Also, this conclusion does not mean that there are no exogenous reasons that could justify the Nash concept in these games. However, the discussion here was concerned with endogenous reasons – i.e. reasons that can be found in the way games are modeled. And there the justification seems deficient.

c. Nash Equilibrium in Repeated Games

If people encounter an interactive situation sufficiently often, they sometimes can find their way to optimal solutions by trial-and error adaptation. In a game-theoretic context, this means that players need not necessarily be endowed with the ability to play equilibrium – or with the sufficient knowledge to do so – in order to get to equilibrium. If they play the game repeatedly, they may gradually adjust their behavior over time until there is no further room for improvement. At that stage, they have achieved equilibrium.

Kalai and Lehrer (1993) show that in an infinitely repeated game, subjective utility maximizers will converge arbitrarily close to playing Nash equilibrium. The only rationality assumption they make is that players maximize their expected utility, based on their individual beliefs. Knowledge assumptions are remarkably weak for this result: players only need to know their own payoff matrix and discount parameters. They need not know anything about opponents’ payoffs and rationality; furthermore, they need not know other players’ strategies, or conjectures about strategies. Knowledge assumptions are thus much weaker for Nash equilibria arising from such adjustment processes than those required for one-shot game Nash solutions.

Players converge to playing equilibrium because they learn by playing the game repeatedly. Learning, it should be remarked, is not a goal in itself but an implication of utility maximization in this situation. Each player starts out with subjective prior beliefs about the individual strategies used by each of her opponents. On the basis of these beliefs, they choose their own optimal strategy. After each round, all players observe each other’s choices and adjust their beliefs about the strategies of their opponents. Beliefs are adjusted by Bayesian updating: the prior belief is conditionalized on the newly available information. On the basis of these assumptions, Kalai and Lehrer show that after sufficient repetitions, (i) the real probability distribution over the future play of the game is arbitrarily close to what each player believes the distribution to be, and (ii) the actual choices and beliefs of the players, when converged, are arbitrarily close to a Nash equilibrium. Nash equilibria in these situations are thus justified as potentially self-reproducing patterns of strategic expectations.

It needs to be noted, however, that this argument depends on two conditions that not all games satisfy. First, players must have enough experience to learn how their opponents play. Depending on the kind of learning, this may take more time than a given interactive situation affords. Second, not all adjustment processes converge to a steady state (for an early counterexample, see Shapley 1964). For these reasons, the justification of Nash equilibrium as the result of an adjustment process is sensitive to the game model, and therefore does not hold generally for all repeated games.

d. Backward Induction

Backward induction is the most common Nash equilibrium refinement for non-simultaneous games. Backward induction depends on the assumption that rational players remain on the equilibrium path because of what they anticipate would happen if they were to deviate. Backward induction thus requires the players to consider out-of-equilibrium play. But out-of-equilibrium play occurs with zero probability if the players are rational. To treat out-of-equilibrium play properly, therefore, the theory needs to be expanded. Some have argued that this is best achieved by a theory of counterfactuals (Binmore 1987, Stalnaker 1999), which gives meaning to sentences of the sort “if a rational player found herself at a node out of equilibrium, she would choose …”. Alternatively, for models where uncertainty about payoffs is allowed, it has been suggested that such unexpected situations may be attributed to the payoffs’ differing from those that were originally thought to be most likely (Fudenberg, Kreps and Levine 1988).

The problem of counterfactuals cuts deeper, however, than a call for mere theory expansion. Consider the following two-player non-simultaneous perfect information game in figure20, called the “centipede”. For reasons of representational convenience, the game is represented as progressing from left to right (instead of from top to bottom as in the usual extensive-form games). Player 1 starts at the leftmost node, choosing to end the game by playing down or to continue the game (giving player 2 the choice) by playing right. The payoffs are such that at each node it is best for the player who has to move to stop the game if and only if she expects that in the event she continues, the game will end at the next stage (by the other player stopping the game or by termination of the game). The two zigzags stand for the continuation of the payoffs along those lines. Now backward induction advises to solve the game by starting at the last node z, asking what player 2 would have done if he ended up here. A comparison of player 2’s payoffs for his two choices, given his rationality, answers that he would have chosen down. Substituting the payoffs of this down for node z, one now moves backwards. What would player 1 have done had she ended up at node y? Given common knowledge of rationality (hence the substitution of player 2’s payoffs for node z) she would have chosen down. This line of argument then continues back to the first node.

Figure 20

For the centipede, backward induction therefore recommends player 1 to play down at the first node; all other recommendations are counterfactual in the sense that no rational player should ever reach it. So what should player 2 do if he found himself at node x? Backward induction tells him to play “down’, but backward induction also told him that if player 1 was rational, he would never face the actual choice at node x. So either player 1 is rational, but made a mistake (‘trembled” in Selten’s terminology) at each node preceding x, or player 1 is not rational (Binmore 1987). But if player 1 is not rational, then player 2 may hope that she will not choose down at her next choice either, thus allowing for a later terminal node to be reached. This consideration becomes problematic for backward induction if it also affects the counterfactual reasoning. It may be the case that the truth of the indicative conditional “If player 2 finds herself at x, then player 2 is not rational” influences the truth of the counterfactual “If player 2 found herself at x, then player 2 would not be rational”. Remember that for backward induction to work, the players have to consider counterfactuals like this: “If player 2 found herself at x, and she was rational, she would choose down”. Now the truth of the first counterfactual makes false the antecedent condition of the second: it can never be true that player 2 found herself at x and be rational. Thus it seems that by engaging in these sorts of counterfactual considerations, the backward induction conclusion becomes conceptually impossible.

This is an intensely discussed problem in game theory and philosophy. Here only two possible solutions can be sketched. The first answer insists that common knowledge of rationality implies backward induction in games of perfect information (Aumann 1996). This position is correct in that it denies the connection between the indicative and the counterfactual conditional. Players have common knowledge of rationality, and they are not going to lose it regardless of the counterfactual considerations they engage in. Only if common knowledge was not immune against evidence, but would be revised in the light of the opponents’ moves, then this sufficient condition for backward induction may run into the conceptual problem sketched above. But common knowledge by definition is not revisable, so the argument instead has to assume common belief of rationality. If one looks more closely at the versions of the above argument (e.g. Pettit and Sugden (1989)), it becomes clear that they employ the notion of common belief, and not of common knowledge.

Another solution of the above problem obtains when one shows, as Bicchieri (1993, chapter 4) does, that limited knowledge of rationality and of the structure of the game suffice for backward induction. All that is needed is that a player, at each of her information sets, knows what the next player to move knows. This condition does not get entangled in internal inconsistency, and backward induction is justifiable without conceptual problems. Further, and in agreement with the above argument, she also shows that in a large majority of cases, this limited knowledge of rationality condition is also necessary for backward induction. If her argument is correct, those arguments that support the backward induction concept on the basis of common knowledge of rationality start with a flawed hypothesis, and need to be reconsidered.

In this section, I have discussed a number of possible justifications for some of the dominant game theoretic solution concepts. Note that there are many more solution concepts that I have not mentioned at all (most of them based on the Nash concept). Note also that this is a very active field of research, with new justifications and new criticisms developed constantly. All I tried to do in this section was to give a feel for some of the major problems of justification that game theoretic solution concepts encounter.

e. Paradoxes of Rationality

In the preceding section, the focus was on the justification of solution concepts. In this section, I discuss some problematic results that obtain when applying these concepts to specific games. In particular, I show that the solutions of two important games disagree with some relevant normative intuitions. Note that in both cases these intuitions go against results accepted in mainstream game theory; many game theorists, therefore, will categorically deny that there is any paradox here at all. From a philosophical point of view (as well as from some of the other social sciences) these intuitions seem much more plausible and therefore merit discussion.

The Chain Store Paradox

Recall the story from section 1c: a chain store faces a sequence of possible small-business entrants in its monopolistic market. In each period, one potential entrant can choose to enter the market or to stay out. If he has entered the market, the chain store can choose to fight or to share the market with him. Fighting means engaging in predatory pricing, which will drive the small-business entrant out of the market, but will incur a loss (the difference between oligopolistic and predatory prices) for the chain store. Thus fighting is a weakly dominated strategy for the chain store, and its threat to fight the entrant is not credible.

Because there will only be a finite number of potential entrants, the sequential game will also be finite. When the chain store is faced with the last entrant, it will cooperate, knowing that there is no further entrant to be deterred. Since the structure of the game and the chain store’s rationality are common knowledge, the last small-business will decide to enter. But since the last entrant cannot be deterred, it would be irrational for the chain store to fight the penultimate potential entrant. Thus, by backward induction, the chain store will always cooperate and the small-businesses will always decide to enter.

Selten (1978), who developed this example, concedes that backward induction may be a theoretically correct solution concept. However, for the chain-store example, and a whole class of similar games, Selten construes backward induction as an inadequate guide for practical deliberation. Instead, he suggests that the chain store may accept the backward induction argument for the last x periods, but not for the time up to x. Then, following what Selten calls a deterrence theory, the chain store responds aggressively to entries before x, and cooperatively after that. He justifies this theory (which, after all, violates the backward induction argument, and possibly the dominance argument) by intuitions about the results:

…the deterrence theory is much more convincing. If I had to play a game in the role of [the chain store], I would follow the deterrence theory. I would be very surprised if it failed to work. From my discussion with friends and colleagues, I get the impression that most people share this inclination. In fact, up to now I met nobody who said that he would behave according to the [backwards] induction theory. My experience suggests that mathematically trained persons recognize the logical validity of the induction argument, but they refuse to accept it as a guide to practical behavior. (Selten 1978, 132-3)

Various attempts have been made to explain the intuitive result of the deterrence theory on the basis of standard game theory. Most of these attempts are based on games of incomplete information, allowing the chain store to exploit the entrants’ uncertainty about its real payoffs. Another approach altogether takes the intuitive results of the deterrence theory and argues that standard game should be sensitive to limitations of the players’ rationality. Some of these limitations are discussed under the heading of bounded rationality in Section 2f.

The One-Shot Prisoners’ Dilemma

The prisoners’ dilemma has attracted much attention, because all standard game theoretic solution concepts unanimously advise each player to choose a strategy that will result in a Pareto-dominated outcome.

C1 C2
R1
2,2
0,3
R2
3,0
1,1

Figure 21: Prisoners’ Dilemma

Recall that the unique Nash equilibrium, as well as the dominant strategies, in the prisoners’ dilemma game is (R2,C2) – even though (R1,C1) yields a higher outcome for each player. In Section 1b, the case of an infinitely repeated prisoners’ dilemma yielded a different result. Finite repetitions, however, still yield the result (R2,C2) from backward induction. That case is structurally very similar to the chain store paradox, whose implausibility was discussed above. But beyond the arguments for (R1,C1) derived from these situations, many also find the one-shot prisoners’ dilemma result implausible, and seek a justification for the players to play (R1,C1) even in that case. Gauthier (1986) has offered such a justification based on the concept of constrained maximization. In Gauthier’s view, constrained maximization bridges the gap between rational choice and morality by making moral constraints rational. As a consequence, morality is not to be seen as a separate sphere of human life but as an essential part of maximization.

Gauthier envisions a world in which there are two types of players: constrained maximizers (CM) and straightforward maximizers (SM). An SM player plays according to standard solution concepts; A CM player commits herself to choose R1 or C1 whenever she is reasonably sure she is playing with another CM player, and chooses to defect otherwise. CM players thus do not make an unconditional choice to play the dominated strategy; rather, they are committed to play cooperatively when faced with other cooperators, who are equally committed not to exploit one another’s good will. The problem for CM players is how to verify this condition. In particular in one-shot games, how can they be reasonably sure that their opponent is also CM, and thus also committed to not exploit? And how can one be sure that opponents of type CM correctly identify oneself as a CM type? With regards to these questions, Gauthier offers two scenarios, which try to justify a choice to become a CM. In the case of transparency, players’ types are common knowledge. This is indeed a sufficient condition for becoming CM, but the epistemic assumption itself is obviously not well justified, particularly in one-shot games – it simply “assumes away” the problem. In the case of translucency, players only have beliefs about their mutual types. Players’ choices to become CM will then depend on three distinct beliefs. First, they need to believe that there are at least some CMs in the population. Second, they need to believe that players have a good capacity to spot CMs, and third that they have a good capacity to spot SMs. If most players are optimistic about these latter two beliefs, they will all choose CM, thus boosting the number of CMs, making it more likely that CMs spot each other. Hence they will find their beliefs corroborated. If most players are pessimistic about these beliefs, they will all choose SM and find their beliefs corroborated. Gauthier, however, does not provide a good argument of why players should be optimistic; so it remains a question whether CM can be justified on rationality considerations alone.

f. Bounded Rationality in Game Players

Bounded rationality is a vast field with very tentative delineations. The fundamental idea is that the rationality which mainstream cognitive models propose is in some way inappropriate. Depending on whether rationality is judged inappropriate for the task of rational advice or for predictive purposes, two approaches can be distinguished. Bounded rationality which retains a normative aspect appeals to some version of the “ought implies can” principle: people cannot be required to satisfy certain conditions if in principle they are not capable to do so. For game theory, questions of this kind concern computational capacity and the complexity-optimality trade-off. Bounded rationality with predictive purposes, on the other hand, provides models that purport to be better descriptions of how people actually reason, including ways of reasoning that are clearly suboptimal and mistaken (for an overview of bounded rationality, see Grüne-Yanoff 2007). The discussion here will be restricted to the normative bounded rationality.

The outmost bound of rationality is computational impossibility. Binmore (1987) discusses this topic by casting both players in a two-player game as Turing machines. A Turing machine is a theoretical model that allows for specifying the notion of computability. Very roughly, if a Turing machine receives an input, performs a finite number of computational steps (which may be very large), and gives an output then the problem is computable. If a Turing machine is caught in an infinite regress while computing a problem, however, then the problem is not computable. The question Binmore discusses is whether Turing machines can play and solve games. The scenario is that the input received by one machine is the description of another machine (and vice versa), and the output of both machines determines the players’ actions. Binmore shows that a Turing machine cannot predict its opponent’s behavior perfectly and simultaneously participate in the action of the game. Roughly put, when machine 1 first calculates the output of machine 2 and then takes the best response to its action, and machine 2 simultaneously calculates the output of machine 1 and then takes the best response to its action, the calculations of both machines enter an infinite regress. Perfect rationality, understood as the solution to the outguessing attempt in “I thank that you think that I think…” is not computable in this sense.

Computational impossibility, however, is very far removed from the realities of rational deliberation. Take for example the way people play chess. Zermelo (1913) long ago showed that chess has a solution. Despite this result, chess players cannot calculate the solution of the game and choose their strategies accordingly. Instead, it seems that they typically “check out” several likely scenarios and that they entertain some method to evaluate the endpoint of each scenario (e.g. by counting the chess pieces). People differ in the depth of their inquiry, the quality of the “typical scenarios” selected, and the way they evaluate their endpoint positions.

The justification for such “piecemeal” deliberation is that computing the solution of a game can be very costly. Deliberation costs reduce the value of an outcome; it may therefore be rational to trade the potential gains from a full-blown solution with the moderate gains from “fast and frugal” deliberation procedures that are less costly (the term “fast and frugal” heuristics was coined by the ABC research group. Compare Gigerenzer et al 1999). Rubinstein (1998) formalizes this idea by extending the analysis of a repeated game to include players’ sensitivity to the complexity of their strategies. He restricts the set of strategies to those that can be executed by finite machines. He then defines the complexity of a strategy as the number of states of the machine that implements it. Each player’s preferences over strategy profiles increase with her payoff in the repeated game, and decrease with the complexity of her strategy’s complexity (He considers different ranking methods, in particular unanimity and lexicographic preferences). Rubinstein shows that the set of equilibria for complexity-sensitive games is much smaller than that of the regular repeated game.

3. Game Theory as a Predictive Theory

We now turn from the use of game theory as a normative theory to its use as a scientific theory of human behavior. Game theory, as part of Rational Choice Theory, is an important social scientific method. There is, however, considerable controversy about the usefulness of Rational Choice Theory for the purposes of the social sciences. Some of this controversy arises along disciplinary boundaries: while Rational Choice Theory is considered mainstream in economics (to the extent that no one even bothers using this label), sociologists and political scientists are more divided. A long debate in those disciplines reached its peak with the publications of Green and Shapiro’s (1994) Pathologies of Rational Choice Theory. In this book, they make two major claims about the scientific usefulness of Rational Choice Theory. First, they argue that Rational Choice Theory is empirically empty: that it has produced virtually no new propositions about politics that have been carefully tested and not found wanting. Second, they argue that the perceived universality claim of Rational Choice Theory is misguided: that even if an empirically successful Rational Choice Theory were to emerge, it would not be any more universal than the middle-level theories that they advocate.

These two claims have been challenged on various fronts. First, it has been pointed out that Green and Shapiro employ inappropriate standards for testing Rational Choice Theory, standards that not even successful theories of the hard sciences would survive (Diermeier 1995). Second, defenders of Rational Choice Theory have argued that Green and Shapiro’s argument relies on a biased selection of rational choice literature to survey; and further, that even in the literature they selected, there are interesting and empirically confirmed propositions that satisfy their minimum requirements (Cox 1999). Third, one can argue that Green and Shapiro’s criticism of Rational Choice Theory as a universal theory goes amiss. In Section 1c, I argued that game theory is in fact not a universal theory of rationality, but rather offers a menu of tools to model specific situations. At least with respect to game theory, therefore, they attack the wrong target: game theory is useful because it is a widely applicable method, which works well in certain circumstances, rather than a universal substantive theory of human behavior.

Although game theory cannot be dismissed as not useful for prediction just because it is part of Rational Choice Theory, game theory has a number of problems of its own that need to be discussed in depth. The first issue is to what extent the role of game theory as a theory of rationality is relevant here. I contrast this possibility with a brief sketch of evolutionary game theory, which abandons the rationality notion altogether. In the consecutive section, I discuss the problems of specifying the payoffs in a game, and thus giving a game model empirical content. Last, I discuss the possibility whether game theory can be tested at all, and investigate a recent claim that indeed game theory has been tested, and refuted.

Game theory may be useful in predicting human behavior for two distinct reasons. First, it may be the case that game theory is a good theory of rationality, that agents are rational and that therefore game theory predicts their behavior well. If game theory was correct for this reason, it could reap the additional benefit of great stability. Many social theories are inherently unstable, because agents adjust their behavior in the light of its predictions. If game theory were a good predictive theory because it was a good theory of rationality, this would be because each player expected every other player to follow the theory’s prescriptions and had no incentive to deviate from the recommended course of action. Thus, game theory would already take into account that players’ knowledge of the theory has a causal effect on the actions it predicts (Bicchieri 1993, chapter 4.4). Such a self-fulfilling theory would be more stable than a theory that predicts irrational behavior. Players who know that their opponents will behave irrationally (because a theory tells them) can improve their results by deviating from what the theory predicts, while players who know that their opponents will behave rationally cannot. However, the prospects for game theory as a theory where prescription and prediction coincide are not very good; evidence from laboratory experiments, as well as from casual observations, often puts doubt on it.

Second, and independently of the question of whether game theory is a good theory of rationality, game theory may be a good theory because it offers the relevant tools to systematize and predict interactive behavior successfully. This distinction may make sense when separating our intuitions about how agents behave rationally from a systematic account of our observations of how agents behave. Aumann for example suggests that

philosophical analysis of the definition [of Nash equilibrium] itself leads to difficulties, and it has its share of counterintuitive examples. On the other hand, it is conceptually simple and attractive, and mathematically easy to work with. As a result, it has led to many important insights in the applications, and has illuminated and established relations between many different aspects of interactive decision situations. It is these applications and insights that lend it validity. (Aumann 1985, 49).

These considerations can lead one to accept the view that the principles of game theory provide an approximate model of human deliberation, which sometimes provides insights into real phenomena (this seems to be Aumann’s position). Philosophy of Science discusses various ways of how approximate models can relate to real phenomena; each has its specific problems, which cannot be discussed here.

Aumann’s considerations can also lead one to seek an alternative interpretation of the Nash concept that does not refer to human rationality, but retains all the formally attractive properties. Evolutive approaches of game theory offer such an interpretation (Binmore 1987 proposed this term in order to distinguish it from the eductive approaches discussed in Section 2). Its proponents claim that the economic, social and biological evolutionary pressure directs human agents, who have no clear idea what is going on, to behavior that is in accord with the solution concepts of game theory.

a. The Evolutive Interpretation

The evolutive interpretation seeks to apply techniques, results, and justifications of assumptions from evolutionary game theory to game theory as a predictive theory of human behavior. Evolutionary game theory was developed in biology; it studies the appearance, robustness and stability of behavioral traits in animal populations. This article cannot do justice even to the basics of this very vibrant and expanding field (for a concise and formal introduction, see Maynard Smith 1982 and Weibull 1995), but instead presents only some aspects relevant to two questions; namely (i), to what extend can standard game theory elements be based on evolutionary game theory? And (ii), does this reinterpretation help in the prediction of human behavior?

Evolutionary game theory studies games that are played over and over again by players drawn from a populations. These players do not have a choice between strategies, but rather are “programmed” to play only one strategy. It is thus often said that the strategies themselves are the players. Success of a strategy is defined in terms of the number of replications that a strategy will leave of itself to play in games of future generations. Rather than determining equilibrium as the consequence of strategic reasoning by rational players, evolutionary game theory determines the stability of a strategy distribution in a population either as the resistance to mutant invasions, or as the result of a dynamic process of natural selection. Its equilibrium concept is thus much closer to the stable state concept of the natural sciences, where different causal factors balance each other out, than the eductive interpretation is.

Evolutionary game theory can be distinguished into a static and into a dynamic approach. The static approach specifies strategies that are evolutionary stable against a mutant invasion. Imagine a population of players programmed to play one (mixed or pure) strategy A. Imagine further that a small fraction of players “mutate” – they now play a strategy B different from A. A strategy is an evolutionary stable strategy (ESS) if for every possible mutant strategy B different from A, the payoff of playing A against the A is higher than the payoff of playing B against A – or, if both payoffs are equal, then the payoff of playing A against B is higher than playing B against B. Note that ESS is a robustness test only against a single mutation at a time. It is assumed that the population that plays an ESS has time to adjust back to status quo before the next mutant invasion begins. It follows from this definition that every ESS is a strategy that is in Nash equilibrium with itself. However, not every strategy that is Nash equilibrium with itself is an ESS.

The dynamic approach of evolutionary game theory considers a selection mechanism that favors some strategies over others in a continuously evolving population. Imagine a population whose members are programmed to play different strategies. Pairs of players are drawn at random to play against each other. Their payoff consists in an increase or decrease in fitness, measured as the number of offspring per time unit. Each offspring inherits the parent’s strategy. Reproduction takes place continuously over time, with the birthrate depending on fitness, and the death rate being uniform for all players. Long continuations of tournaments between players then may lead to stable states in the population, depending on the initial population distribution. This notion of dynamic stability is wider than that of evolutionary stability: while all evolutionary stable strategies are also dynamically stable, not all dynamically stable strategies are evolutionary stable. It has been shown that in the long run, all strictly dominated and all iteratively strictly dominated strategies are eliminated from the population. The relation between stable states and Nash equilibria is more complex, and would require specifications that go beyond the scope of this brief sketch.

Evolutionary game theory provides interesting concepts and techniques that are quite compatible with the solution concepts of standard game theory discussed in Section 1 (however, it focuses mainly on two-person static games; dynamic games and game repetitions are less investigated). Clearly, evolutionary game theory is more concerned with discovering conditions of stability and robustness of strategies in populations, than with finding the equilibria of a single game. The question that remains is whether it competes in its explanatory efforts with eductive game theory, or whether it deals instead with different (although maybe related) phenomena.

Those who claim that explanatory efforts between these two interpretations do compete hope that evolutionary concepts will replace players’ rationality – better even, that they will explain why we sometimes think that players are rational. This hope is well illustrated at the hand of Binmore’s evolutive model and the criticism directed against it. Binmore’s approach starts with the concept of a meme – “a norm, an idea, a rule of thumb, a code of conduct – something that can be replicated from one head to another by imitation or education, and that determines some aspects of the behavior of the person in whose head it is lodged” (Binmore 1994, 20). Players are mere hosts to these memes, and their behavior is partly determined by them. Fitness is a property of the meme and its capacity to replicate itself to other players. Expected utility maximization is then interpreted as a result of evolutionary selection:

People who are inconsistent [in their preferences] will necessarily be sometimes wrong and hence will be at a disadvantage compared to those who are always right. And evolution is not kind to memes that inhibit their own replication. (Binmore 1994, 27)

This is of course a version of the dynamic approach discussed above. To that extent, the theory of the fittest memes becoming relatively more frequent is an analytic truth, as long as “fitness” is no more than high “rate of replication”. But Binmore then transfers the concept of strategy fitness to player rationality. Critics have claimed that this theory of meme fitness cannot serve as the basis for the claim that the behavior of human individuals as hosts of memes will tend towards a rational pattern. The error occurs, Sugden (2001) argues, when Binmore moves from memes fitness to fitness of players. In the analogous biological case – which is based on genes instead of memes – the reproductive success of phenotype depends on the combination of genes that carry it. Genes have positive consequences in combination with some genes while bad consequences in combination with others. A gene pool in equilibrium therefore may contain genes which, when brought together in the same individual by a random process of sexual reproduction, have bad consequences for that individual’s survival and reproduction. Therefore, genes may be subject to natural selection, but there may be a stable proportion of unfit phenotypes produced by them in the population. It is thus not necessarily the case that natural selection favors phenotype survival and reproduction. The same argument holds for memes: unless it is assumed that an agent’s behavior is determined by one meme alone, natural selection on the level of memes does not guarantee that agents’ behavioral patterns are rational in the sense that they are consistent with expected utility theory. It therefore remains an empirical question whether people behave in accord with the principles game theory proposes. The evolutive interpretation cannot determine a priori that players will play Nash equilibrium.

b. The Problem of Alternative Descriptions

While intuitions about rational behavior may be teased out in fictional, illustrative stories, the question of whether prediction is successful is answerable only on the basis of people’s observed behavior. Behavioral game theory observes how people behave in experiments in which their information and incentives are carefully controlled. With the help of these experiments, and drawing on further evidence from psychology, it hopes to test game-theoretic principles for their correctness in predicting behavior. Further, in cases where the tests do not yield positive results, it hopes that the experiments suggest alternative principles that can be included in the theory (for more details on Behavioral Game Theory, their experimental methods and results, see Camerer 2003). To test game theory, the theory must be made to predict particular behavior. To construct specific experimental setups, and to make the theory predict such particular behavior, however, particular interactive phenomena need to be modeled as games, so that the theory’s solution concepts can be applied. This brings with it the problem of interpretation discussed in Section 1c. The most contentious aspect of a game modeling lies in the payoffs. The exemplary case is the disagreement over the relevant evaluations of the players in the Prisoners’ Dilemma.

Some critics of the defect/defect Nash equilibrium solution have claimed that players would cooperate because they would not only follow their selfish interests, but also take into account non-selfish considerations. They may cooperate, for example, because they care about the welfare of their opponents, because they want to keep their promises out of feelings of group solidarity or because they would otherwise suffer the pangs of a bad conscience. To bring up these considerations against the prisoners’ dilemma, however, would expose a grave misunderstanding of the theory. A proper game uses the players’ evaluation, captured in the utility function, of the possible outcomes, not the material payoff (like e.g. money). The evaluated outcome must be described with those properties the players find relevant. Thus either the non-selfish considerations are already included in the players’ payoffs (altruistic agents, after all, also have opposing interest – e.g. which charitable cause to benefit); or the players will not be playing the Prisoners’ Dilemma. They will be playing some other game with different payoffs.

Incorporating non-material interests in the payoffs has been criticized for making game theory empirically empty. The critics argue that with such a broad interpretation of the payoffs, any anomaly in the prediction of the theory can be dissolved by a re-interpretation of the agents’ evaluations of the consequences. Without constraints on re-interpretation, the critics claim, the theory cannot be held to any prediction.

To counter this objection, many economists and some game theorists claim to work on the basis of the revealed preference approach. At a minimum, this approach requires that the preferences – and hence the utility function – of an agent are exclusively inferred from that agent’s choices (for a discussion of the revealed preference account, see Grüne 2004). This ostensibly relieves game modelers to engage in “psychologizing” when trying to determine the players’ subjective evaluations.

However, it has been argued that the application of the revealed preference concept either trivializes game theory or makes it conceptually inconsistent. The first argument is that the revealed preference approach completely neglects the importance of beliefs in game theory. An equilibrium depends on the players’ payoffs and on their beliefs of what the other players believe and what they will do. In the stag hunt game of figure 1, for example, Row believes that if Col believed that Row would play R2, then he would play C2. But if the payoff numbers represented revealed preferences, Hausman (2000) argues, then they would say how individuals would choose, given what the other chose, period. The payoffs would already incorporate the influence of belief, and belief would play no further role. Game theory as a theory of rational deliberation would have lost its job.

The second criticism claims that it is conceptually impossible that games can be constructed on the basis of revealed preferences. Take as an example the simple game in figure 22.

Figure 22: A game tree

How can a modeler determine the payoff pairs z1-z4 for both players according to the revealed preference method? Let’s start with player 2. Could one construct two choice situations for player 2 in which he chooses between z1 and z2 and between z3 and z4 respectively? No, argues Hausman (2000): two thus constructed choice situation exactly differ from the game in figure 22 in that they are not preceded by player 1’s choice. Hence there is no reason why it could not be the case that player 2 chooses z1 over z2 in the game but chooses z2 over z1 in the constructed choice situation. More problematically still, player 2 must be able to compare z1 with z3 and z2 with z4. But it is logically impossible that she will ever face such a choice, as player 1 will choose either U or D. Last, turning to player 1, she never faces a choice between the outcomes of this game, only between U and D. So the revealed preference theorist cannot assign preferences over outcomes to player 1 at all, and to player 2 only partially. With the preferences that he can assign – to player 2’s played strategy, and to player 1’s choices – prediction is only possible at the pain of trivializing game theory. The only prediction that the revealed preference theorist now can offer is that the players play whatever action they revealed prefer – that is, they do what they do.

These problems may have contributed to a widespread neglect of the problem of preference ascription in game theoretic models. As Weibull (2002) observes:

While experimentalists usually make efforts to carefully specify to the subject the game form … they usually do not make much effort to find the subject’s preferences, despite the fact that these preferences constitute an integral part of the very definition of a game. Instead, it is customary to simply hypothesize subjects’ preferences. (Weibull 2002, 2)

The problem of preference identification has been insufficiently addressed in rational choice theory in general and in game theory in particular. But it is not unsolvable. One solution is to find a criterion for outcome individuation. Broome offers such a criterion by justifiers: “outcomes should be distinguished as different if and only if they differ in a way that makes it rational to have a preference between them” (Broome 1991, 103). This criterion, however, requires a concept of rationality independent of the principles of rational choice. A rational choice is no longer based on preferences alone, but preferences themselves are now based on the rationality concept. This constitutes a radical departure of how most rational choice theorists, including game theorists, regard the concept of rationality. Another option that Hausman (2005) suggests is that economists can use game theoretic anomalies to study the factors influencing preferences. By altering features of the game forms and, in particular, by manipulating the precise beliefs each player has about the game and about others’ conjectures, experimenters may be able to make progress in understanding what governs choices in strategic situations and hence what games people are playing.

c. Testing Game Theory

Whether game theory can be tested depends on whether the theory makes any empirical claims, and whether it can be immunized against predictive failure.

Does the theory make testable claims? At first, it does not seem so. The theory as discussed in Sections 1a-1b mainly takes the form of theorems. Theorems are deductive conclusions from initial assumptions. So to test game theory, these assumptions need to be tested for their empirical adequacy. In this vein, Hausman (2005) claims that game theory is committed to contingent and testable axioms concerning human rationality, preferences, and beliefs. This claim remains controversial. Many economists believe that theories should not be tested with regard to their assumptions, but only with respect to their predictions (a widespread view that was eloquently expressed by Friedman 1953). But the theory only makes empirical claims in conjunction with its game models.

Further, testing game theory through its predictions is difficult as such tests must operate through the mediation of models that represent an interactive situation. Here the issue of interpreting the modeled situation (see Section 1c) and of model construction drives a wedge between the predicting theory and the real world phenomena, so that predictive failures can often be attributed to model misspecification (as discussed in section 3b).

Guala (2005) recently pointed to a specific element of game theory that seems to make an empirical claim all by itself, and independent of auxiliary hypotheses. For this purpose, he discusses the phenomenon of reciprocity. Agents reciprocate to other agents who have exhibited “trust” in them because they want to be kind to them. Reciprocation of an agent 1 to another agent 2 is necessarily dependent on 2 having performed an action that led 1 to reciprocate. Reciprocation is thus clearly delineated from general altruism or justice considerations.

The question that Guala raises is whether reciprocity can be accounted for in the payoff matrix of a game. The ‘kindness’ of an action depends on what could have been chosen: I think that you are kind to me because you could have harmed me for your benefit, but you elected not to. This would mean that the history of chosen strategies would endogenously modify the payoffs, a modeling move that is explicitly ruled out in standard game theory. Guala shows that the exclusion of reciprocity is connected right to the core of game theory: to the construction of the expected utility function. All existing versions of the existence proof of expected utility theory rely on the so-called rectangular field assumption. It assumes that decision makers form preferences over every act that can possibly be constructed by combining consequences with states of the world. However, if reciprocity has to be modeled in the consequences, and reciprocity depends on others’ acts that in turn depend on the players’ own acts, then it is conceptually impossible to construct acts in accord with the rectangular field assumption, because the act under question would be caught in an infinite regress.

If Guala’s argument is correct, it seems impossible to model reciprocity in the payoffs, and game theory is not flexible enough to accommodate reciprocity considerations into its framework. But that would mean that game theory claims that reciprocity does not exist in general. With this claim, game theory would be testable, and – if reciprocity were indeed a relevant factor in strategic decisions, as the evidence seems to suggest – would be refuted.

4. Conclusion

Game theory, this survey showed, does not provide a general and unified theory of interactive rationality; nor does it provide a positive theory of interactive behavior that can easily be tested. These observations have many implications of great philosophical interest, some of which were discussed here. Many of the questions that arise in these discussions are still left unanswered, and therefore require more attention from philosophers than they currently receive.

This article could only sketch the basic concepts of game theory in order to discuss some of their philosophical implications and problems. Wherever possible, it abstained from presenting any formal detail. To fully understand game theory, however, a formal treatment is inevitable. A good and fun introduction that also points out some philosophical issues is Binmore (1991). A textbook that puts more emphasis on the mathematical proofs is Osborne and Rubinstein (1994); a thorough and technical treatment (including excellent bibliographies) is Fudenberg and Tirole (1991). Some of the graphs found in this article were taken from that book.”

See also the discussions of game theory in these articles: Law and Economics, Egoism, Libertarianism, and Social Contract Theory.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Aumann, Robert. “What is Game Theory Trying to Accomplish?” Frontiers of Economics. Ed. K Arrow and S. Honkapojah. Oxford: Blackwell, 1985.
  • Aumann, Robert. “Backward Induction and Common Knowledge of Rationality,” Games and Economic Behavior 8 (1995): 6-19.
  • Bacharach, Michael. “Variable Universe Games,” Frontiers of Game Theory. Ed. Binmore, Kirman and Tani. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1993. 255-75.
  • Brandenburger, Adam. “Knowledge and Equilibrium in Games,” Journal of Economic Perspectives 6 (1992): 83-101.
  • Bernheim, D. “Rationalizable Strategic Behavior,” Econometrica 52(1984): 1007-1028.
  • Bicchieri, Christina. Rationality and Coordination. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
  • Binmore, Ken. “Modeling Rational Players: Part I,” Economics and Philosophy 3 (1987): 179-214.
  • Binmore, Ken Fun and Games, D.C. Heath, 1991.
  • Binmore, Ken. Game Theory and the Social Contract. Volume I: Just Playing. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1994.
  • Broome, John. Weighting Goods. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991. Camerer, Colin F. Behavioral Game Theory. Princeton NJ: Princeton University Press, 2003.
  • Cox, Gary W. “The Empirical Content of Rational Choice Theory: A Reply to Green and Shapiro,” Journal of Theoretical Politics 11(1999): 147-166.
  • Diermeier, Daniel “Rational Choice and the Role of Theory in political Science,” Critical Review 9 (1995): 59-70.
  • Ellsberg, Daniel. “Theory of the Reluctant Duelist,” The American Economic Review 46/5 (1956): 909-923.
  • Friedman, Milton. “The methodology of positive economics,” in Essays in Positive Economics. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1953, pp. 3-43.
  • Fudenberg, Kreps and Levine. “On the Robustness of Equilibrium Refinements,” Journal of Economic Theory 44 (1988): 354-380.
  • Fudenberg and Maskin. “The Folk Theorem with Discounting and with Incomplete Information,” Econometrica 54 (1986): 533-554.
  • Fudenberg, Drew and Jean Tirole. Game Theory. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1991.
  • Gauthier, David. Morals by Agreement. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1986
  • Gigerenzer, G., Todd, P. & the ABC Research Group (1999). Simple heuristics that make us smart. New York: Oxford University Press..
  • Goeree Jacob K. and Charles A. Holt “Ten Little Treasures of Game Theory and Ten Intuitive Contradictions,” American Economic Review 91/5 (2001): 1402-1422.
  • Green, Donald and Ian Shapiro. Pathologies of Rational Choice Theory, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, 1994.
  • Grüne, Till. “The Problems of Testing Preference Axioms on the Basis of Revealed Preference Theory,” Analyse und Kritik 26/2 (2004): 382-397.
  • Grüne-Yanoff, Till “Bounded Rationality,” Philosophy Compass, Basil Blackwell, Vol. 2 (3): 534-563, 2007.
  • Grüne-Yanoff, Till and Sven Ove Hansson “Preferences,” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Edward N. Zalta (ed.), http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/preferences/, 2006.
  • Grüne-Yanoff, Till and Paul Schweinzer “The Role of Stories in Applying Game Theory,” Journal of Economic Methodology, 2008.
  • Guala, Francesco (2006) “Has Game Theory Been Refuted?” The Journal of Philosophy 103 (55): 239-263.
  • Hausman, Danniel M. “Revealed Preferences, Belief and Game Theory,” Economics and Philosophy 16 (2000): 99-115.
  • Hausman, Daniel M. “’Testing’ Game Theory,” Journal of Economic Methodology 12:2 (2005): 211-223.
  • Jacobsen, Hans Jørgen. “On the Foundations of Nash Equilibrium,” Economics and Philosophy 12 (1996): 67-88.
  • Kalai, Ehud and Ehud Lehrer. “Rational Learning Leads to Nash Equilibrium,” Econometrica 61/5 (1993): 1019-1045.
  • Kuhn, Harold W. “Extensive Games and the Problem of Information,” Contributions to the Theory of Games. Ed. Harold W. Kuhn and A. W. Tucker. Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1953.
  • Levi, Isaac. “Prediction, Deliberation, and Correlated Equilibrium,” The Covenant of Reason. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997: 102-117.
  • Luce, R. Duncan and Howard Raiffa. Games and Decisions. New York: Wiley, 1957.
  • Morgan, Mary. “The Curious Case of the Prisoner’s Dilemma: Model Situation? Exemplary Narrative?” Science without Laws. Ed. A. Creager, M. Norton Wise and E.
  • Nash, John. “Equilibrium Points in n-Person Games,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Science 36 (1950): 48-49.
  • von Neumann, John and Oskar Morgenstern. The Theory of Games and Economic Behavior. Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1944.
  • Osborne, Martin and Ariel Rubinstein. A Course in Game Theory. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1994.
  • Pearce, David G. “Rationalizable Strategic Behavior and the Problem of Perfection,” Econometrica 52/4 (1984): 1029-1050.
  • Pettit, Philip and Robert Sugden “The Backward Induction Paradox,’ The Journal of Philosophy 86/4 (1989): 169-182.
  • Risse, Matthias. “What is Rational About Nash Equilibria?” Synthese 124 (2000): 361-384.
  • Rubinstein, Ariel. “Comments on the Interpretation of Game Theory,” Econometrica 59/4 (1991): 909-924.
  • Rubinstein, Ariel Modeling Bounded Rationality, MIT Press, 1998.
  • Schelling, Thomas. The Strategy of Conflict. Cambridge Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1960.
  • Selten, Reinhard. “The Chain Store Paradox.” Theory and Decision 9/2 (1978): 127-159.
  • Shapley, Lloyd S. “Some Topics in Two-Person Games,” in Advances in Game Theory, M. Dresher, Lloyd S. Shapley and A. W. Tucker, eds., Princeton University Press,1-28, 1964.
  • Stalnaker, Robert. “Knowledge, Belief and Counterfactual Reasoning in Games,” The Logic of Strategy. Ed. C. Bicchieri, R. Jeffrey, B. Skyrms. Oxford University Press, 1999.
  • Sugden, Robert. “A Theory of Focal Points,” Economic Journal 105 (1995): 1296-302.
  • Sugden, Robert. “The Evolutionary Turn in Game Theory,” Journal of Economic Methodology 8/1 (2001): 113-130.
  • Weibull, Jörgen W. Evolutionary Game Theory. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1995.
  • Weibull, Jörgen W. “Testing Game Theory,” Mimeo, 2004.
  • Young, H. Peyton. Individual Strategy and Social Strategy: An Evolutionary Theory of Institutions. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2001.
  • Zermelo, Ernst. “Über eine Anwendung der Mengenlehre auf die Theorie des Schachspiels,” Proceedings of the Fifth International Congress on Mathematics, 1913.

Author Information

Till Grüne-Yanoff
Email: gruneyan@mappi.helsinki.fi
University of Helsinki
Finland

Hell

In philosophy and theology, the word “hell,” in its most general sense, refers to some kind of bad post-mortem state. The English word is apparently derived from an Indo-European word meaning “to cover,” which is associated with burial, and by extension, with a “place of the dead.” Accounts of hell’s nature describe these dimensions:

  • The duration of hell: is it temporary or permanent?
  • The felt quality of hell: is it a state of consciousness, or lack of consciousness? If the former, what is it like to be in hell?
  • The purpose of hell: why do some people go there?

Some Eastern religions teach that after death, people suffer conscious punishment for their sins before eventually being reincarnated. However, this ‘temporary hell’ plays a relatively peripheral role in these religions, which aim primarily at escaping the cycle of rebirth altogether. Therefore, this article concentrates on philosophical issues surrounding the doctrine of hell as it has arisen in the theistic religions of Judaism, Christianity, and Islam. In these, hell is central to traditional eschatological teachings about a last judgment. This is the culminating event of history, in which God bodily resurrects the dead and separates the righteous or saved (those with love for or faith in God) from the wicked, admitting the saved to some kind of heaven or paradise, and damning the wicked to a permanent hell.

Section One explains several alternative understandings of what hell is like. On the traditional Christian model of hell, articulated by some of the West’s most historically significant philosophers and theologians, hell involves permanent, conscious suffering for the purpose of punishing human sin. According to annihilationism, the damned ultimately cease to exist and so are not conscious. According to the free will view of hell, the purpose of hell is to respect the choice of the damned not to be with God in heaven. Finally, according to universalism, there is either no hell at all, or only a temporary hell. Section Two considers the ‘problem of hell’ (which is a particular form of the general philosophical problem of evil): if, as theistic religions traditionally have taught, God is all-powerful, all-knowing and completely good, it seems morally and logically impossible that God would allow anyone to be utterly and ineradicably ruined, as the damned in hell would seem to be. Advocates of the traditional view normally respond to this problem by claiming that hell is a function of impartial divine justice; this line of response is explored in Section Three. Finally, Section Four explains how the free will view deals with the problem of hell.

Table of Contents

  1. The Nature of Hell
    1. The Traditional View
      1. The Literal View
      2. Psychological Views
        1. Harsh Psychological View
        2. Mild Psychological View
    2. Annihilationism
    3. Free Will View
    4. Universalism
  2. The Problem of Hell
  3. Hell and Justice
  4. Hell and Freedom
  5. References and Further Reading

1. The Nature of Hell

a. The Traditional View

The Tanakh/Bible contains various images of the last judgment. One striking picture in Hebrew scripture occurs at the end of Isaiah (66:22-24). [Quotations from the Bible are from the New Revised Standard Version.] Faithful Jews, who will “remain before” God in a prosperous “new heavens and new earth,” “shall go out and look at the dead bodies of the people who have rebelled against [God], for their worm shall not die, their fire shall not be quenched, and they shall be an abhorrence to all flesh.” In the Gospel of Mark (9:48), Jesus appropriates this imagery in describing hell as a place “where their worm never dies, and the fire is never quenched.” In the Gospel of Matthew (25:31-46), Jesus teaches that at the last judgment, those who failed to care for “the least of my family” will “go away into eternal punishment,” which is “the eternal fire prepared for the devil and his angels.” Elsewhere in Matthew (8:12, 22:13, 24:51, and 25:30), Jesus invokes a rather different image, suggesting that hell is “outer darkness” (that is, outside heaven) “where there will be weeping and gnashing of teeth.” He teaches that many will seek to enter heaven but be shut out (Luke 13:22-30), suggesting that there is no way to escape from hell once there. Finally, the Christian Bible’s closing book (Revelation 20:7-15) describes the devil, along with Death, Hades, and “anyone whose name was not found written in the book of life,” being cast “into the lake of fire and sulfur . . . and they will be tormented day and night forever and ever.” The Qur’an teaches that hell is “a prison-house” (17:8) in which “those who disbelieve and act unjustly . . . shall remain forever” (4:168) to receive “a sufficient recompense” (9:68) for their sins. There they will “…burn in hellfire. No sooner will their skins be consumed than [God] shall give them other skins, so that they may truly taste” divine wrath (4:55). [Quotations from the Qur’an are from the translation by N. J. Dawood (Penguin Books, 1974).]

Reflection on these scriptural images has given rise to the traditional view of hell. The passage from Isaiah, in which the residents of hell are dead bodies, suggests that hell is a state of unconscious existence, or perhaps even non-existence. While some of the Gospel passages may fit with this view, the ones about weeping and gnashing of teeth seem to suggest instead that the residents of hell are conscious of their bad condition. Furthermore, the passages from Revelation and the Qur’an suggest that the denizens of hell experience torment (extreme conscious suffering). So, on the traditional view, the felt quality of hell is suffering (this implies that the damned exist and are conscious), and its purpose is to punish those who have failed to live faithfully in this life. With respect to duration, the traditional view teaches that the suffering of hell is not only permanent, but necessarily permanent, because there is no possible way for the damned to escape hell once there as a irreversible consequence of their sins. Different versions of the traditional view spring from different understandings of the suffering involved in hell.

i. The Literal View

In the harshest version – which takes much of the scriptural imagery literally – hell involves extreme forms of both mental and physical suffering. On the Day of Judgment, the dead will all be physically resurrected, and the bodies of the damned will be consigned to a literal lake of fire. According to Augustine, this fire will cause a physical agony of burning, but will not consume the flesh of the damned, so that their agony will never end. Furthermore, the damned will suffer psychologically: their most powerful desire will be to escape from hell, but they will realize that escape is impossible, and so will experience not only frustration, but despair. Furthermore, as Augustine puts it, they will be “tortured with a fruitless repentance.” (Book 9) Realizing that their own actions have placed them in this miserable position, they will be filled with regret and self-loathing.

ii. Psychological Views

Some traditionalists object that the literal view of hell, as a place of physical torment, presents God as sadistic. They prefer to see the scriptural images of fire, darkness, and so forth as potent symbols or metaphors for the psychological suffering of hell. Because humans were made for God, their most fundamental desire (whether they consciously acknowledge it or not) is to enjoy eternal union with God. As a state of eternal separation from God, hell would frustrate this central human desire. Therefore, even if the damned felt physical pleasure, they would still experience psychological suffering: frustration, despair, regret, and self-loathing. This ‘psychological suffering only’ view of hell can be further subdivided into harsher and milder views concerning the extent to which the damned suffer.

1) Harsh Psychological View

On the harsher view of psychological suffering, the torments of hell will cause the damned to see clearly, perhaps for the first time, that they truly desire union with God. Although this epiphany will bring them to genuine repentance and willingness to obey God, it will be ‘too late’ for them to enter heaven, for hell is necessarily an eternal state, from which there is no escape. On the harsh model, the damned really want to leave hell, but can’t.

Although this view fits with some scriptural imagery noted above (in which people try to enter heaven and are turned away), it is difficult to reconcile with the idea that God loves all people, including the damned. It would seem that a truly repentant denizen of hell would have attained the very same psychological state of love for God that the blessed in heaven enjoy. Therefore, it is hard to imagine that a loving God would want to keep such a person in hell (and to suggest that God might want to admit such people to heaven, but be unable to do so, would be to do deny God’s omnipotence).

Against this objection, some may argue that God does not in fact love all people, but only the elect, who are predestined for salvation. Others might point out that heaven is a reward for loving God in the unclear conditions of mortal life; those repenting only after God has made things clear to them would fail to merit heaven in the same way as the blessed (however, this argument would be difficult for many Christians to make, given their stress on the importance of divine grace, rather than individual merit, in the process of salvation).

2) Mild Psychological View

In the milder view of psychological suffering, while the damned may have a desire to leave hell and enter heaven, they would also wish to remain as they are: self-obsessed, morally vicious, etc. This view contends that the damned continually act on their desire to remain the same, and so are unwilling to repent and submit to God. If they seek to enter into heaven, it is only on their own terms. This is a ‘mild’ version of hell because, though the damned suffer in hell, they do not suffer badly enough to want (all things considered) to leave. In their vicious state, they could not enjoy union with God, and so prefer hell.

The mild view is easier to reconcile with the idea that God loves even the damned; if a denizen of hell were to genuinely repent, God would admit such a person to heaven. Thus, hell will be a permanent state for the damned only because they will never repent. There are two ways to explain why the damned will refuse to repent.

First, they may be unable to repent, because they have lost their freedom to choose what is truly good. In this case, hell is necessarily eternal; it is not possible for the damned to escape from hell once they arrive there. Second, the damned may be able to repent, but remain eternally unwilling to do so. That is, while the damned will actually remain in hell for all eternity, it is possible for their stay in hell to be temporary, since they could repent and be admitted to heaven.

This second explanation of eternal damnation is actually a departure from the traditional view of hell. As noted above, the traditional view teaches that the duration of hell is necessarily eternal because it is not possible for the damned to escape. This second view, according to which hell is eternal, but not necessarily eternal, is discussed here only because it is so close to the traditional view and does not have a widely accepted label. [The closest thing to an established label comes from Kvanvig (1993), which uses the term “second chance theory of hell” for any view denying that it is impossible for the damned to escape hell. See pages 71-73.]

It could be objected that on either version of the mild view, hell is not a form of punishment because it is not imposed on the damned against their will. However, it does not seem that all punishment must be contrary to the will of its recipient. It seems rather that punishment is a negative consequence demanded by justice, regardless of whether or not the one punished wishes to be punished. For example, if justice demands that God remove the ability of the damned to repent, then this removal would seem to be a form of punishment (one which shapes, rather than opposes, the wills of the damned).

b. Annihilationism

Annihilationism (also known as the ‘conditional immortality’ view) teaches that ultimately the damned cease to exist, and so are not conscious for all eternity. Whereas the traditional view is comprehensive in the sense that it specifies the purpose, duration, and the felt quality of hell, annihilationism is a thesis only about the last of these categories. Therefore, it is possible for annihilationists to take different positions on the overall nature of hell. They normally assume that once God annihilates a person, she will never again come into existence; annihilation is a permanent state. However, annihilationists disagree about God’s reason for annihilating the damned. Many see annihilation as retributive punishment for sin, while others think that God annihilates the damned out of love for them (this will be discussed further in section four).

According to annihilationism, the ultimate fate of the damned does not involve suffering (because it is a state of non-existence). However, it is open to annihilationists to assert that God puts the damned through a period of conscious suffering (enough, perhaps, to ‘pay them back’ for their sins) before finally snuffing out their existence. Descriptions of this temporary conscious suffering could vary in harshness along the lines described above for the traditional view.

The best argument for annihilationism derives from the traditional theistic doctrine of divine conservation: all things depend on God to conserve their existence from moment to moment, and so exist only so long as they are connected to God in some way. But if hell is complete and utter separation or disconnection from God, then hell would be a state of non-existence. Against annihilationism, some would object that it is contrary to God’s creative nature to annihilate anything (this will be discussed further in section four).

c. Free Will View

The free will view is primarily a thesis about the purpose of hell. It teaches that God places the damned in hell not to punish them, but to honor the choices they have freely made. On this view, hell originates not so much from divine justice as from divine love.

According to the free will view, one of God’s purposes in creation is to establish genuine love-based relationships between God and humans, and within the human community. But love is a relation that can exist only between people who are genuinely free. Therefore, God gives people freedom in this life to decide for themselves whether or not they will reciprocate God’s love by becoming the people God created them to be. People freely choose how they act, and through these choices they shape their moral character (a collection of stable tendencies to think, feel, and act, in certain ways). Those who develop a vicious character suffer psychologically, both in this life and in the life to come, for in the afterlife, people will keep the character they have developed in this life. So the suffering of hell consists (at the least) in living with one’s own bad character.

The question may arise: Why does God not simply alter the character of vicious people after they die, so that they become virtuous and God-loving denizens of heaven? Some would argue that such alteration would be too radical to preserve personal identity over time: the person admitted to heaven, though in many ways similar to the original vicious person, would not be numerically the same person because of serious differences in moral character; in altering the vicious person, God would be, in effect, annihilating her and replacing her with a numerically distinct virtuous counterpart. Against this argument, it could be claimed that even if instantaneous transformation would undermine personal identity, an omnipotent God could surely transform vicious people through a more gradual process that preserves personal identity. But even if it is possible, adherents of the free will view would consider such divinely-engineered transformation deeply inconsistent with the divine plan. For if God remade vicious people into saints, the humans’ new attitude toward God would not be truly their own, thus removing the genuineness of the love relationship between God and creature.

The free will view’s emphasis on character formation leads quite naturally to the Roman Catholic doctrine of purgatory. Because of their bad character, vicious people cannot have an afterlife entirely devoid of suffering. Those in purgatory, though initially vicious, are able and willing to repent, freely receiving a good character from God; therefore their suffering is temporary and they eventually enter into heaven. Those in hell, on the other hand, are either unable or unwilling to repent; the only afterlife God can give such people is an afterlife of self-inflicted suffering.

One pressing question for the free will view is why God gives the damned an afterlife at all, rather than simply letting them cease to exist at death (a version of annihilationism). This, and other objections to the free will view, will be discussed in section four.

Like annihilationism, the free will view is not a comprehensive view of hell, and so is subject to variation. It can be combined with either the claim that the damned suffer consciously for all eternity, or the claim that they are (eventually) annihilated. Another point of variation concerns post-mortem freedom: some teach that the damned have the ability after death to continue freely choosing and shaping their character, while others claim that the damned are locked into their vicious characters, unable to change.

d. Universalism

Strictly speaking, universalism is not a view of what hell is like, but it is nevertheless an important view relevant to any discussion of hell. Universalism teaches that all people will ultimately be with God in heaven. There are two main versions of the view. According to necessary universalism, it is not possible for anyone to be eternally separated from God; necessarily, all are saved. According to contingent universalism, while it is possible that people could use their free will to reject God forever, no one will actually do this; eventually, everyone will say yes to God’s love. While it would be consistent with the basic universalist thesis to say that all people go immediately to heaven upon death, most universalists (in an effort to incorporate scriptural warnings about hell) insist that many people will undergo a temporary period of post-mortem suffering before entering heaven. This period of suffering, which could be seen as a temporary hell or as a kind of purgatory, could be motivated either by divine justice, as in the traditional view of hell, or by divine love, as in the free will view.

2. The Problem of Hell

Atheists have leveled two different ‘arguments from evil’ against the existence of God (see Evil, Evidential Problem of, and Evil, Logical Problem of). According to the evidential argument from evil, we would not expect a world created by a necessarily omnipotent, omniscient, morally perfect being (that is, an ‘omniperfect’ God) to contain suffering of the kinds and amounts that we actually experience; therefore, though the suffering (i.e. evil) we see does not logically imply the non-existence of an omniperfect God, it does count as evidence against God’s existence. According to the logical argument from evil, it is not even logically possible for an omniperfect God to coexist with evil. Given the evident existence of evil, it is impossible for there to be an omniperfect God. Furthermore, since religious belief systems normally assert the existence of both God and evil, they are internally incoherent.

The problem of hell is a version of the logical problem of evil, and can be stated thus:

(1) An omniperfect God would not damn anyone to hell without having a morally sufficient reason (that is, a very good reason based on moral considerations) to do so.

(2) It is not possible for God to have a morally sufficient reason to damn anyone.

(3) Therefore, it is not possible for God to damn anyone to hell.

This argument concludes that if there is an omniperfect God—one that necessarily has the perfection of Goodness—then no one will be damned. Therefore traditional theological systems, which insist on both damnation and God’s omniperfection, are incoherent and must be revised. Theologians must give up either the doctrine of damnation or the traditional understanding of God as omniperfect.

In light of the above argument, those who retain their belief in God’s omniperfection have two options: embrace necessary universalism, or challenge the soundness of the argument. The argument is valid, so those who wish to reject it must deny one of its premises.

The argument’s first premise seems to follow from the nature of the relevant divine attributes. To say that a being is morally perfect is (in part) to say that such a being would not want any suffering to occur unless there were a morally sufficient reason for it to occur. God’s omnipotence and omniscience imply that God has knowledge and power sufficient to ensure that things happen only if God wants them to happen. So it seems that a perfectly good, omnipotent, and omniscient being would not allow suffering – particularly of the extreme sort associated with damnation – unless there was a very good moral justification for allowing it.

The second premise of the argument is much more controversial, however. Anti-universalists (i.e. those who affirm both divine omniperfection and damnation) have denied the premise in two different ways. The first is simply to deny that, given our finite minds, we can be sure that (2) is true. Is it not at least possible for God to have a morally sufficient reason for allowing damnation? Perhaps there is some great good (which we cannot now, and perhaps never will, grasp) that God cannot realize without the damnation of souls. Leibniz (c. 1672) suggests one possible example of such a good: the overall perfection of the universe. It may be that God brings about the damnation of some because preventing their damnation would have made the overall story of the universe less good. While a view such as Leibniz’s may be appealing to moral utilitarians, people with more Kantian moral intuitions will object that a God who pursues the perfection of the universe (or any other unseen good) at the expense of the damned is not morally perfect at all, but is instead using the damned as a mere means to divine ends (see Kant’s Ethics).

Second, anti-universalists can claim that (2) is certainly false because we know of a morally sufficient reason for God to allow damnation. They have proposed two such reasons. The first, and historically the most popular, is justice: if God failed to damn the wicked, God would be acting unjustly—acting in collusion with the wicked—and so would be morally imperfect. The second, more popular in the last century, is freedom: if God necessitated the salvation of everyone, then God would be removing human freedom to say “no” to God in an ultimate way, and consequently the value of saying “yes” to God would be significantly diminished.

3. Hell and Justice

Many defenders of the traditional view of hell claim that though God is loving, God is also just, and justice demands the eternal punishment of those who sin against God. However, others often object that far from demanding damnation, justice would prohibit it, since there would be a discrepancy between the temporary, finite crimes committed by the sinner and the everlasting, infinite punishment inflicted by God. Some see such reasoning as favoring annihilationism: if hell is punishment, then it must involve (at most) a finite amount of conscious suffering followed by annihilation. On the other hand, capital punishment (the earthly analogue of annihilation) is usually considered a more serious punishment than life imprisonment without parole (which could be considered analogous to eternal conscious punishment).

The following ‘infinite seriousness’ argument aims to show that justice not only permits God to damn some (contra the objection above), but actually demands it.

(4) Other things being equal, the seriousness of a crime increases as the status (the degree of importance or value) of its victim increases.

(5) God has an infinitely high status.

(6) Therefore, crimes against God are infinitely serious (from (4) and (5)).

(7) All sin is a crime against God.

(8) Therefore, all sin is infinitely serious (from (6) and (7)).

(9) The more serious a crime is, the more serious its punishment should be.

(10) Therefore, all sin should receive an infinitely serious punishment (from (8) and (9)).

Premise (9) is relatively uncontroversial, because it seems to be just cashing out part of what we mean when we talk about the “seriousness” of a crime. To say that a crime is not serious is (in part) to say that does not merit a serious punishment; to say that a crime is moderately serious is to say that it deserves a moderately severe penalty, and so on. Premise (5) is also uncontroversial, since an infinitely perfect being would seem to have infinite value and importance. However, some of the other premises of the infinite seriousness argument are subject to dispute.

At first glance, (7) may seem false: how can Smith’s theft of Jones’ wallet wrong God, especially if Smith is unaware of God’s existence and so cannot intend the theft to be directed against God? However, many believe that when one person is sufficiently precious to, and dependent upon, another, a wrong committed against the first person automatically wrongs the second. For example, harm done to an infant is arguably also harm done to the infant’s mother. But if all things depend on God for their continued existence, and all people are precious to God, then by the same principle it would seem that God is wronged by all sin, even if the sinner does not intend to wrong God.

Premise (4), which claims that seriousness of a crime is a function not only of the nature of the crime itself and the harm it causes, but also of the status of the victim(s) wronged by the crime, seems to fit with some widely shared moral intuitions. For example, other things being equal, killing a human (a higher status victim) seems to be a much more serious crime than killing a neighbor’s dog (a lower status victim). However, when the harm against a victim is indirect (e.g., by means of harming someone precious to the victim), it is not clear that the victim’s status is relevant to the seriousness of the crime. Other things being equal, killing a saint’s best friend seems no worse than killing a criminal’s, even though the saint would arguably enjoy a higher social status. On the other hand, this may not be a genuine counterexample to the first premise, because saints and criminals are both of the same natural kind (humanity); perhaps all the infinite seriousness argument needs is a principle according to which harms against beings of more ontologically perfect kinds are more serious than harms against beings of less perfect kinds.

Finally, as Jonathon Kvanvig (1993) notes, factors such as the criminal’s intentions are relevant to determining the appropriate degree of punishment for a crime. For example, premeditated murder is normally considered more serious than murder committed in a fit of passion. Therefore, it seems that not all sin deserves the same degree of punishment, even if all sin is against God. Insofar as damnation would inflict the same punishment (eternal separation from God) for all sin, it would be fundamentally unjust. This objection would seem to vitiate even annihilationist conceptions of hell, if they see annihilation as punishment. In response, it could be suggested that although all the damned are given an infinitely lengthy punishment, more serious criminals are placed in more harsh conditions. Or perhaps it could be claimed that although not all sins deserve infinite punishment, everyone commits at least one infinitely serious sin at some point in life, and so would deserve infinite punishment.

Even if the infinite seriousness argument is sound, the idea of divine mercy creates difficulties for a defense of the traditional view of damnation, as follows. Suppose that every person deserves damnation. Theistic religions teach that God is willing to forgive the sins of the faithful, so that they will not receive their just punishment. But if God is able and willing to forgo the punishment in one case, why not in all cases? There are two main (seemingly incompatible) responses to this question. Some claim that if God were to forgive everyone, this would display God’s mercy, but not God’s justice. Therefore, because God seeks to reveal all the divine attributes, God cannot will the salvation of all. Others insist that although God is willing to forgive everybody, not everyone is willing to ask for, or accept, God’s forgiveness, resulting in self-inflicted retribution.

4. Hell and Freedom

Because the traditional view of hell understands the purpose of damnation to be retribution for sin, it would seem to stand or fall with the infinite seriousness argument. As discussed at the end of section one, however, those who see hell as an expression of divine love have proposed an entirely different morally sufficient reason for God to allow damnation: respect for freedom. In the free will view, damnation is the only possible way for God to honor the freedom of the damned. To force the sinners into heaven against their wills would not, in this view, be an act of Divine love. Instead, God respects human autonomy by allowing us to shape our character through our own free choices, and by refusing to unilaterally change the character we have chosen; if in this life, we freely develop into morally vicious and miserable people, then that is how God will allow us to remain for eternity.

But if the only possible eternity open to the damned is one of fundamental ruin and despair, why would God give them a never-ending afterlife? Would it not be more loving of God to let the damned cease to exist at death (or, if justice demands it, after a temporary postmortem period of punishment)? The two main versions of the free will view require different lines of response to this question. Those who deny post-mortem freedom might insist that only the guaranteed existence of an eternal afterlife (good or bad) can render our ante-mortem choices truly momentous. Therefore, to guarantee the importance of our earthly freedom, God must give an afterlife to everyone. For those who affirm post-mortem freedom, God gives the damned a never-ending afterlife (at least in part) so that they can continue to choose whether to accept or reject God’s love. Indeed, some who defend the free will view suggest that because our earthly freedom and knowledge with respect to God are often very limited (indeed, because God’s very existence is not evident to many), no one would be in a position to make a truly decisive choice for or against God until the afterlife, in a situation where the agent had a clearer understanding of what was at stake. The subsequent discussion will focus on versions of the free will view that posit post-mortem choice.

The free will view assumes an incompatibilist account of free will, according to which a person is genuinely free with respect to her choices only if she (or an event involving her) is the ultimate causal determinant of those choices. Therefore, if God causally determined denizens of hell to repent, then God—rather than the humans—would be the ultimate determining cause of the repentence, and the humans would not be the agent of their own repentance. Those that hold the compatibilists view concerning free will and determinism claim that free actions can be causally predetermined, as long as the chain of causes runs through the will and intellect of the free agent in an appropriate way. If compatibilism is correct, then God could determine everyone to enter heaven freely, by first causing them to desire heaven enough to repent. Therefore, in claiming that God cannot both (1) give creatures genuine freedom and (2) guarantee that all will be saved , the free will view relies on incompatibilism, which is a very controversial view. For more on the compatibilist/incompatibilist controversy, see the entry on Free Will.

Even if an incompatibilist notion of freedom is taken for granted, it is not clear that the desire to honor human free choices would provide God with a morally sufficient reason to allow damnation. To see why, consider an analogous human situation. Perhaps parents should, out of respect for their children’s freedom, allow them to harm themselves in relatively insignificant ways. But as the degree of self-harm increases, it becomes less and less clear that non-intervention is the loving parental policy. Could it ever be truly loving to allow one’s child to, say, commit suicide? If the child were very young, or did not clearly understand the nature or consequences of her choice, then it would seem clearly wrong for the parent not to do everything in her power to stop the suicide. But if the child is both fully mature and fully cognizant of her choice and its ramifications, then some would consider parental intervention a violation of the child’s rightful autonomy. Insofar as the free will view appeals to God’s respect for the freedom and autonomy of the damned, it seems to conceive of the damned as related to God in something like the way an adult child is related to a parent. Those who see humans as more like infants in relation to God – because of the vast gap between divine and human power – will probably not be persuaded by the free will view.

Another possible objection to the free will view concerns the relationship between freedom and rationality. Free choices, if they are to have any real value, must be more than simply random or uncaused events—they must be explicable in terms of reasons. Free action must be a species of rational action. But there seems to be no reason to choose eternal suffering (or non-existence) over an eternity of bliss. The choice to remain in hell would be utterly irrational, and so could not count as a genuinely free choice. Defenders of the free will view would likely counter this objection by distinguishing between objective and subjective reasons. If people amass enough false beliefs, then what is in fact bad or harmful can seem good or beneficial to them. So perhaps the choice to remain in hell, while admittedly not objectively rational, could be motivated by the damned person’s subjective reasons (that is, by how things seem to him or her). Even if this line of defense is successful, it leaves open questions about the value of freedom in such cases: is it really a good thing for agents to have the power to act in ways that bring about their own objective ruin?

Although the freedom view does not rule out the traditional picture of hell as eternal existence apart from God, some would argue that it requires openness to other possibilities as well. What would happen, for example, if the damned hated God to such an extent that they would prefer non-existence to retaining even the slightest dependence on God? It would seem that God as depicted in the free will view would (out of respect for the freedom of the damned) give them what they wished for, unless there were a good reason not to. Thus, in the freedom view it would seem possible that the damned may end in annihilation. Hell would then be disjunctive: it could involve eternal conscious suffering or annihilation. Advocates of the free will view who favor a more traditional conception of hell can respond to the foregoing argument by positing some reason for God not to honor a damned person’s choice for annihilation. Here are four possible responses.

First, some suggest that souls, once created, are intrinsically immortal, and cannot be destroyed even by God. Most theists would not find this suggestion plausible, however, because it seems to do away with divine omnipotence.

Second, perhaps annihilating the damned would violate God’s moral principles. According to Stump (1986), Aquinas believed that being and goodness are convertible, and so considered morality to require that God never destroy a being unless doing so would promote an even greater level of being/goodness. Since annihilating a damned soul would decrease being without a compensating increase in being elsewhere in the universe, God is morally bound not to do it. This view could be criticized (as was Leibniz’s view above) for giving insufficient weight to the idea that God is first and foremost good to individuals, and only secondarily concerned with abstract issues like the amount of being in the universe.

Third, God might refuse to annihilate the damned because it is better for them (regardless of global considerations) to go on existing, because existence itself is a significant good for those who enjoy it. On the other hand, in using phrases like “a fate worse than death,” people seem to presuppose that the goodness of existence can be outweighed by negative features of existence. Therefore, if the sufferings of hell are serious enough, they could make continued existence there even worse for the damned than non-existence. So whether we consider this third suggestion (that eternal conscious separation from God is better for the damned than annihilation) to be plausible will depend on how bad we consider non-existence to be, and how bad we consider the felt quality of hell to be.

Fourth, God might refuse to annihilate the damned out of hope. This claim could be endorsed even by those who believe that an eternity of conscious separation from God would be worse than non-existence. We would think it right to interfere in the attempted suicide of a young person with temporary depression, because of her hope for a brighter future. Similarly, it would seem right for God to keep the damned in existence (even if this existence is temporarily worse than non-existence for them) if there were some hope that they might repent. Out of respect for freedom, God would not unilaterally alter the character of the damned so as to cause their repentance, but out of love and hope God would refuse to allow the damned to extinguish the possibility of reconciliation. If God allows the damned to continue in their suffering only out of hope that they may repent, then no one (not even God) can be certain that the damned will go on suffering eternally. For if God knew (through middle knowledge) that the damned would never freely repent, then God would have no reason to prolong their suffering.

For those who favor the fourth explanation over the first three, the freedom view faces a dilemma regarding the eternity of hell. On the one hand, if there is no hope that the damned will repent, God would seem to have no reason not to honor their (possible) choice for annihilation, thus rendering hell (understood as a state of conscious suffering) possibly temporary. On the other hand, if there is hope that a person in hell will repent, then while God would not honor a choice for annihilation, there is still the possibility for hell to be temporary, since a person who fully repented would eventually go to heaven. On this latter, hopeful, scenario, hell becomes not a place of everlasting retributive punishment, but a place of indefinitely long therapeutic punishment, aimed at the ultimate reconciliation of sinners with God. While it remains possible that some people will in fact hold out against God forever, on the freedom view the functional role of hell is very similar to that of purgatory in Roman Catholic theology: a state of being aimed at leading a person to heaven, through the removal of character flaws that would prevent her from enjoying beatific intimacy with God. The main difference is that the inhabitants of purgatory are certainly destined to join with God in heaven, while the inhabitants of hell face an uncertain future.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Adams, Marilyn M. (1993) ‘The Problem of Hell: A Problem of Evil for Christians’, in E. Stump (ed.) Reasoned Faith, A Festschrift for Norman Kretzmann, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 301–27.
    • An explanation of the problem of hell, advocating for universalism.
  • Augustine, City of God, Book 21.
    • Articulates and defends a literal version of the traditional Christian view of hell.
  • Crockett, William, ed. (1997) Four Views on Hell. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans Publishing Co.
    • Advocates of the literal view, the psychological view, annihilationism, and purgatory take turns explaining their own views and responding to the views of the others.
  • Kvanvig, Jonathan L. (1993) The Problem of Hell. New York: Oxford University Press.
    • An extremely thorough study of philosophical issues surrounding the problem of hell; argues at length against a retributive model of hell and in favor of love as the divine motivation for hell.
  • Leibniz, G. W. (c. 1672) The Philosopher’s Confession.
    • Proposes a ‘best possible world’ defense of damnation.
  • Lewis, C.S. (1946) The Great Divorce. London: MacMillan.
    • A psychologically astute fictional story about heaven and hell; it assumes something like the free will view.
  • Stump, Eleonore (1986) ‘Dante’s Hell, Aquinas’s Moral Theory, and the Love of God’, Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 16:181-196.
    • Attributes a version of the free will view to Dante and shows that it can be defended on Aquinas’ moral principles.
  • Swinburne, Richard (1983) ‘A Theodicy of Heaven and Hell’, The Existence & Nature of God, ed. Alfred J. Freddoso, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press. pp. 37-54.
    • An articulation and defense of the free will view highlighting the importance of character formation; considers annihilation as well as eternal existence as possibilities for the damned.
  • Talbott, Thomas B. (1999) The Inescapable Love of God. Universal Publishers.
    • An extended argument for universalism.
  • Walls, Jerry (1992) Hell: The Logic of Damnation. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
    • A defense of the free will view, emphasizing the need for postmortem choice.

Author Information

C. P. Ragland
Email: raglandc@slu.edu
Saint Louis University
U. S. A.

Autism

Autism, or the Autistic Spectrum Disorder, is a developmental psychological disorder that begins in the early stages of infancy and affects a child’s ability to develop social skills and engage in social activities. Three current psychological/philosophical theories attempt to explain autism as the result of certain cognitive deficiencies. Each theory takes a different approach to the autistic disorder and theorizes different causes. While no theory is without its difficulties, each different approach to the autistic disorder has played an important role in developing the philosophical understanding of social cognition.

Autism is more prevalent, roughly four times more, in males than females. As a disorder, it only has existed as a recognized clinical entity for sixty years and recent research indicates that it is more widespread in the population than is currently appreciated. Persons with autism show various difficulties in social skills, cognitive processing and other co-occurring behavioral and physical problems. The latter include repetitive movements such as hand-waiving or rocking, self-injurious behavior (in cases of extreme autism) and problems with digestion. Autism has become a nationwide issue with numbers of support groups, websites and research programs. Autism has also become influential in many discussions within philosophical psychology.

Autism has played a strong ancillary role in many debates concerning social cognition, how it develops and its structure. Because persons with autism lack the basic abilities to think about others, understanding autism may give us a window into understanding much or all of social cognition. Analogous to the role lesion studies and other neuropsychological disorders play in our understanding of cognition, brain structure and function and neural organization, autism may provide valuable insight into social cognition. The study of autism, with its specific constellation of behavioral and cognitive deficiencies, may be able to highlight the structure, development and nature of social cognition in general.

This article begins with the clinical definition of autism from the DSM-IV, then discusses the role autism has played in three main theories of cognition: Theory of Mind (hereafter ToM), Simulation Theory and the Executive Control or Metacognitive theory. Finally, there is a brief discussion of the role autism still plays in understanding social cognition.

Table of Contents

  1. The Clinical Properties of Autism
  2. Autism and Theory of Mind
  3. Executive Control/Metacognitive Approaches to Autism
  4. Autism and Simulation Theory
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. The Clinical Properties of Autism

Persons with autism show severely diminished or abnormal social interaction and communication, as well as a restricted repertoire of activities and interests (DSM-IV, p. 66). These symptoms can be mild, seen in a lack of certain nonverbal behaviors such as eye-to-eye gaze and gestures or any type of social interaction, or a more serious lack of all reciprocal social interaction and other large impairments in language development and language use. The autistic child may lack close social ties or the abilities to act as “friends” normally with other children. They also may prefer to play alone rather than with others.

The DSM-IV provides the following checklist as a guide to diagnosing autism:

A. A total of six (or more) items from (1), (2), and (3), with at least two from (1), and one each from (2) and (3):

  1. qualitative impairment in social interaction, as manifested by two of the following:

    (a) marked impairment in the use of multiple non-verbal behaviors such as eye-to-eye gaze, facial expression, body postures, and gestures to regulate social interaction.(b) failure to develop peer relationships appropriate to developmental level

    (c) A lack of spontaneous seeking to share enjoyment, interests, or achievements with other people (e.g., lack of showing, bringing, or pointing out objects of interest)

    (d) Lack of social reciprocity

  2. qualitative impairments in communication as manifested in at least one of the following:

    (a) delay in, or total lack of, the development of spoken language (not accompanied by an attempt to compensate through alternative modes of communication such as gesture or mime)(b) in individuals with adequate speech, marked impairment in the ability to initiate or sustain a conversation with others

    (c) stereotyped and repetitive use of language or idiosyncratic language

    (d) lack of varied, spontaneous make-believe play or social imitative play appropriate to developmental level

  3. restricted repetitive and stereotyped patterns of behavior, interests, and activities, as manifested by at least one of the following:

    (a) encompassing preoccupation with one or more stereotyped and restricted patterns of interest that is abnormal in either intensity or in focus(b) apparently inflexible adherence to specific, nonfunctional routines or rituals

    (c) stereotyped and repetitive motor mannerisms (e.g., hand or finger flapping or twisting, or complex body movements)

    (d) persistent preoccupation with parts or objects

B. Delays or abnormal functioning in at least one of the following areas, with onset prior to age three years: (1) social interaction, (2) language as used in social communication, or (3) symbolic or imaginative play.

C. The disturbance is not better accounted for by Rett’s disorder or Childhood Disintegrative Disorder.

These guidelines intentionally lack specificity to account for the wide variety of symptoms and severity found in cases of autism. One of the more well-known cases of autism, is that of Temple Grandin, who holds a PhD in animal science and teaches at Colorado State University. Professor Grandin teaches classes and runs her own business. These are not the kinds of accomplishments expected from a person diagnosed with autism. The more stereotypical case is the child who neither communicates with others nor seems to want to leave their solitary world. Autism derives its name from the intense feeling one gets of the “aloneness” of the autistic person. Even a brief survey of the literature on autism would suffice to show that people diagnosed with autism have varying degrees of impairment.

The clinical and diagnostic features of autism are given to give the philosophical reader a more direct understanding of how clinicians often view the disorder. While such issues are not typically germane to philosophical discussions, they are important in understanding the disorder.

2. Autism and Theory of Mind

Autism has played an important role in theories of cognition in philosophical psychology. The first approach with which we will deal is the Theory of Mind [ToM] approach to development and its treatment of autism. The phrase “ToM approach” is used as a general marker for that family of theories that takes our knowledge of other minds to be innate and basic (See Baron Cohen, 1995; Carruthers, 1996; and Botterill & Carruthers, 1999 for related ToM views on development and autism). Further, the ToM approach often holds that ToM cognition is subtended by modules of a sort. The work of Simon Baron-Cohen is seminal and is generally taken to be the locus classicus of these approaches.

The following example with help us to better understand the type of socio-cognitive knowledge many theories of social cognition attempt to explain. Imagine two close friends have just come back from a night of trick-or-treating one Halloween and have commenced surveying the candy they received. Sam, being an aficionado of hard candy, begins to gather all those types of pieces into a pile. Sam’s compatriot Alice, on the other hand, is a connoisseur of chocolate and he is reminded of this when he sees her collecting all the chocolates into a pile. As Sam separates his candies from one another he mentions to Alice that he would be willing to trade his chocolates for her candies.

This interaction depends upon the one person representing to themselves the preferences of another. This is the sort of knowledge that the that ToM studies. Sam knows that Alice likes chocolate. Alice knows that Sam has chocolates and might be willing to trade. As this example shows, understanding and recognizing the preferences, desires and beliefs of others plays an important role in our interactions.

Baron-Cohen (1995) believes that our ability to mindread, or understand the beliefs and desires of others and how they influence subsequent behavior, is the result of four separate modules/mechanisms working together in order to produce beliefs about what others know. The mindreading system is broken down into the following four modules, ID- the Intentionality Detector, EDD- Eye Direction-Detector, SAM- the Shared Attention Mechanism, and the ToMM-Theory of Mind Module/mechanism. Each of these four mechanisms line up, roughly, with properties in the world, which are: volition (desires), perception, shared attention and epistemic states (knowledge and belief).

The first mechanism Baron-Cohen describes is the Intentionality Detector (ID) (Baron-Cohen, 1995, p. 32). The ID is a perceptual device that interprets the motion of objects in terms of primitive volitional mental states like goal and desire. A more general rendering of this sort of interpretation would be “Object wants/desires x.” Humans use this because it makes sense of basic animal behaviors like approach and avoidance. In order to interpret motion in this way, one needs only two conceptual states: want and goal. The ID is activated whenever there is any perceptual input that might be identified as an agent. We also interpret certain stimuli in the modality of touch, sound, and other modalities in an intentional fashion (Baron-Cohen, 1995, p. 36). If we back up into something we may take it to be a person, and thus say “pardon me.” Only after we verify that it is not a person do we look around to make sure no one was watching us talk to no one in particular.

The second device is the Eye Detection Device (EDD) (Baron-Cohen, 1995, p. 38). The EDD works only through the visual sensory mode. It has three functions: detecting the presence of eyes or eyelike devices; computing which direction the eyes are pointing; and inferring that if another organism’s eyes are directed toward a thing, then it sees that thing. It is important on Baron-Cohen’s view that the third function be seen as giving the organism with the EDD the ability to posit mental states about the organism it is viewing. A new mental state, “one of knowing or believing that some other creature may have visual access to” is added to the basic/primitive mental states of the child. The second and third functions of the EDD are important for Baron-Cohen. Baron-Cohen believes that it is highly adaptive to be able to make a judgment about another being’s knowledge, such as when the tiger has prey in its sights (see Baron-Cohen, 1995 pp. 32-36). If one calculates that the tiger has its eyes trained on a friend, and one uses their knowledge that eyes are used to see (extrapolation from self and third function of the EDD), then one should realize that the tiger sees one’s friend and probably will want to attack. This is called a dyadic representation: Agent sees X. The ID and EDD can form dyadic representations that are relations between two objects or people. It resembles the story told about the tiger. With the ID one can interpret the tiger as an agent. If the agent sees ones friend, and eating is a desire of the tiger, then one might realize that my friend is in danger.

The third mechanism we will deal with is the shared attention mechanism, or SAM (Baron-Cohen, 1995 pp. 44-50). The SAM’s sole function is building triadic representations. The triadic representation expresses a relation between object, Self, and agent. The representation is put generally thus: [I-see- (tiger-sees my friend)]. The SAM compares input from the ID and the EDD and forms these triadic representations. Continuing the tiger example, with a slight modification, will help. If one sees the tiger prowling (ID), sees your friend some yards away, and sees that the tiger is in a position to see your friend (EDD), the SAM can now extrapolate that both the tiger and you see your friend. Furthermore, if you know that tigers like to hunt humans, you might then warn your friend of his impending lunch date.

In this scenario the SAM makes available the ID’s inference that the tiger has a goal, which one interprets through experience, to the EDD and then reads the eye direction in terms of the agent’s inferred goals. With this information one might surmise, according to the example, that the tiger would, more than likely, eat your buddy. After reaching this conclusion one may yell to try and warn your friend of her danger. With all of this in place we can see that this use of primitive representations could be very adaptive and helpful in navigating through a world that has agents who act with goal directed activity.

The final mechanism in Baron-Cohen’s architecture is the Theory of Mind Module/Mechanism (ToMM) (Baron-Cohen, 1995 pp. 50-55). The ToMM has a number of distinct functions. The ToMM is a cognitive system that allows the human to posit a wide range of mental states from observed behavior— to employ a theory of mind in parsing the behavior of others. We learn that upon seeing a desired item, ceteris paribus, people will likely try to get that item. We also learn that people can often misrepresent the world and that these false-beliefs might lead to behaviors that are explainable only in terms of this false belief. The ToMM is the one mechanism/module that we can utilize in order to understand and codify what we learn about mental/epistemic states. The ToMM gives us the ability to represent epistemic states. These epistemic states include believing, pretending, and dreaming. The final responsibility of the ToMM is be able to put the various epistemic states together to allow us to understand how these pieces work together in mental life. The ToMM has a grand job according to Baron-Cohen: “It has the dual function of representing the set of epistemic mental states and turning all this mentalistic knowledge into a useful theory” (Baron-Cohen, p. 51).

The ToMM has multiple functions. It first processes representations of propositional attitudes of the form: [Agent-Attitude-“Proposition”]. An example is “Selma believes that it is wintery.” This is a different ability than having a mental representation of, “It is wintery today.” It differs because one’s belief about Selma is a representation of what one takes her to believe about the world. Having these sorts of representations is crucial to the ability to represent epistemic mental states. The ToMM also allows us to infer that a person will attempt to obtain what they desire if they believe that they are likely to succeed.

For many ToM researchers, the problems persons with autism show in a variety of ToM tasks is evidence for the innate basis of our cognitions about other minds. For example, persons with autism do poorly on the false-belief task. Persons with autism typically use less mental state attribution in their speech compared with average functioning persons and IQ matched developmentally delayed children. Persons with autism also fail to recognize surprise based emotions in others (Harris, 1989). However, persons with autism do show preserved cognitive function in areas as diverse as mathematics, music and mnemonic capacities. These preserved cognitive abilities in persons with autism support a dissociation which furthers the case that ToM knowledge is separate, and thus likely etiologically different, from other cognitions.

The ToM approach generally finds socio-cognitive knowledge to be innate and highly structured. It is not without its problems, however. Some argue (Fodor, 1998) that the modularity relied upon as a basis for the explanation is not plausible given the nature of modules. Further, persons with autism show a wide range of socio-cognitive abilities (high and low functioning persons with autism) that seems to be further evidence against the modular nature of social cognition. As a result, some argue that other theories provide better explanations of the autistic disorder.

3. Executive Control/Metacognitive Approaches to Autism

An alternative to the ToM view of knowledge and development is known as the Executive Control or Metacognitive theory. Executive Control Theorists propose that our ability to understand the mental states of others is the result of the development and use of more general cognitive and metacognitive processes such as metarepresentation, the self monitoring cognitive activity and problem solving. Metarepresentation is the ability that our minds have to represent a representation or have beliefs about beliefs. So, on Executive Control theory, to represent to myself a belief state of someone else, i.e. “I believe my friend sees my chocolate is in the bowl,” one does so with the understanding that one is representing the belief state of another. According to the Executive Control view, these highly complex cognitions require certain cognitive resources which develop over time and practice. Furthermore, the ability to represent the mental states of others is not native. The metarepresentation of another’s epistemic state is the result of applying general cognitive strategies and abilities within a specific domain.

On the Executive Control approach the mind is a domain general information processor able to utilize a wide variety of cognitive resources across a number of domains in solving problems. Executive Control models of cognition and cognitive development state that most of our upper level cognitive abilities are subtended by the same basic sets of cognitive resources. Our ability to pretend, to problem solve and anticipate the actions of others based on inferred thoughts we take a person to have all stem from basic general cognitive abilities. We use the same sets of cognitive resources to solve problems in math, the social arena and learning our own phone number. Understanding others’ behaviors in a social setting is particular problem that humans must face. In order to understand this arena, we simply use these other cognitive skills within the social domain.

Executive Control models rely on a traditional psychological division of labor in the mind that separates memory into long-term memory (LTM) and short-term or working memory (STM). We also have certain cognitive abilities such as the development and use of certain problem solving strategies and the ability to metarepresent. In addition to the strategies one uses to solve problems, one must also be able to generate a plan or method of solving problems that one can implement. As such, the mind is generally able to organize and reorganize activities as a person solves a problem. “Executive function is defined as the ability to maintain appropriate behaviors such as planning, impulse control, inhibition of prepotent but relevant responses, set maintenance, organized search, and flexibility of thought and action” (Ozonoff, et al., 1991, p. 1083). For example, since Alice (a teacher) knows that she wants to be home by 3:00 this afternoon, she realizes that she must finish up the writing she’s scheduled for today. She must also meet with students. If she realizes that student meetings tap her energy leaving her unsuitable for writing, she must then plan to write before meetings if she wants to accomplish her goals.

According to the executive control model, in certain problem solving situations we are able to monitor our strategies for result and economy and make changes with these goals in mind. In the above case, Alice might simply schedule meetings on days that she does not intend to write so that she might more effectively write on the other days. We can also monitor our performance in reaching certain goals. If it turns out that the division-of-academic-labor plan is not working, Alice may alter that plan. She might even inhibit the tendency they have to allow other factors of their job to take time away from writing. If she stumbles onto a procedure that works well in getting them “primed” to write, she might adopt its use. There are many tests used to evaluate our executive control abilities, but the problem confronting experimentalists is that it is often hard to develop a task that reliably taps one set of skills or abilities. However, there are some direct tests, one of the more famous of which is the Tower of Hanoi Puzzle, which researchers rely on to test executive abilities.

In the Tower of Hanoi tests, participants follow certain rules in order to accomplish the task of moving the stack of discs from one area to the next. Imagine that you are presented with three poles the rightmost of which has three discs of differing sizes. The goal is then to move the configuration of discs you are presented with, largest disc on the bottom followed by the next smallest on top and then the smallest on top of that, to the leftmost pole. You are told that while you accomplish this task you can only move one disc at a time, you cannot place a larger disc onto a smaller one and that you need to accomplish the move in the fewest possible number of moves possible. As you might imagine, initial solutions usually involve mistakes and a great many more moves than is necessary. Persons with poor executive control (children, patients with certain frontal lobe problems, persons with autism, etc.) typically perform poorly on the Tower of Hanoi task. The reason for these failures is clear, according to the Executive Control theorist.

To perform well on the tower task requires the ability to plan a solution. It also requires remembering all the necessary rules that constrain choice. This task also measures the inhibition of prepotent responses, the first of which is to just start moving the discs over to the leftmost pole. Unfortunately, this is not necessarily the wisest first move. If it is the case that persons with autism typically do poorer on this task, this shows that they have poor executive control abilities. There has been some early research that showed persons with autism to do poorly on executive control tasks (Ozonoff, S., Pennington, B. and Rogers, S., 1991), but recent research is beginning to weaken this conclusion (Ozonoff, S. and Strayer, D., (2001).

Other tests of Executive Control function include a variety of card sorting tasks that require the participant to sort the cards based on color, shape, category, etc. Participants are not told the rule for sorting that will be used during the test. They must figure it out as a result of the response from the experimenter affirming or denying the given response. For example, a set of cards will have animals and artifacts that are colored either red or blue. If the rule the experimenter is using is based on color, the participant, provided there are no conditions preventing the learning of the rule, will figure that the proper rule is “like colored cards with like colored cards.” However, at a certain point during the test, after the participant has shown they are using the proper rule, the rule changes and requires that we sort according to object type (artifact or natural object). In order to succeed, the participant must become aware of this rule change and alter their responses accordingly. This test focuses on strategy, perseverance, and the inhibition of prepotent responses and flexibility of action. As with the Tower of Hanoi puzzle, persons with poor overall executive control do poorly on such tasks. While the abilities tested in the Tower of Hanoi and card sorting tasks are certainly necessary for the development of our understanding of other minds, they do not represent the full complement of skills required for awareness of the thoughts of others. There are still other abilities and skills necessary.

On the Executive Control theory, social knowledge comes from our ability to pretend which allows us to metarepresent. Pretence, for many Executive Control theorists, is critically important to the development of metarepresentation (Jarrold et al., 1993). The skills involved with pretence are exactly the same skills required when we begin to think about other minds. When we engage in pretence we are able to divorce the representation of the object from the object itself: the representation becomes decoupled. This allows children the crucial move that separates representation from the object. Once this ability is practiced, the child then realizes that the representation of the object is different from the object itself. Upon the realization that the mind represents and can have representations about the world that are not tied directly to the world (i.e. pretending the hall runner is a parking lot for cars) they are then able to metarepresent a variety of epistemic states.

In order to self-represent the belief state of another, children must be able to understand that they themselves hold representations of the world. They further understand that others have the same types of relations to the world with their thoughts. Children can then create a metarepresentation of the person who has some sort of perceptual contact with the world and then, based on that metarepresentation, can predict what that person would do in a given situation. For instance, if Sam knows that Alice saw him hide his candy in the box under his bed, then he could suspect that she might go to the hiding spot if she wants some chocolate. Such metarepresentational abilities also allow us to recognize the so-called “false-belief” states of others. Sam must be able to recognize that Alice saw him put the chocolate in the box under his bed, know that he changed the hiding spot unbeknownst to her and realize that she wouldn’t know that the hiding spot had changed since she never saw me move the chocolate. She would have a false-belief based on his particular epistemic relation to the word that he realizes to be inaccurate. Understanding that someone has a false belief also requires that the user have cognitive control over the contents of his mind so that he does not confuse his own beliefs about the world with what they take others to believe. Only after these ancillary abilities are developed can the child succeed in recognizing the false-beliefs of others. Note that these complex chains of thought require a large working memory span that tracks not only my wants (to keep the chocolate for myself), but also the desires and beliefs of another (Alice wants the chocolate and believes it’s where Sam first hid it).

A result of this particular view about cognition, development and our metarepresentational abilities is a markedly different approach and explanation of the disorder autism than we encountered with the ToM approach. Instead of taking the root problem of autism to be due to a failure of some mechanism/module dedicated to the processing of certain social stimuli, the metacognitive approach finds that autism is the result of an inadequate working memory, which allows us to metarepresent (Keenan, 2000). The autistic disorder is the result of a failing of the Executive Control mechanism responsible for inhibiting certain responses, problems in working memory, recall and inflexible and perseverative problem-solving strategies (Ozonoff, et al., 1991). The failure of persons with autism on typical false-belief tasks is the result of being unable to differentiate their own views from another’s during recall (Hughes, 2002). They might also adopt the improper strategy of relying on their own personal beliefs, either by confusing which set of beliefs belongs with whom or simply forgetting which belief is theirs, in answering questions about others’ beliefs. The problem facing persons with autism and causing their suite of behavioral problems is thus a general inability to accurately store and recall information rather than a specific focal deficit in understanding mental states.

4. Autism and Simulation Theory

Simulation Theory (ST) is usually offered in contrast to other approaches and has is supported more by philosophers than psychologists. While ST traditionally received less critical notice than competing approaches, recently a variety of researchers have ardently and eloquently defended it (such as Alvin Goldman, Robert Gordon and Gregory Currie, Paul Harris and Ian Ravenscroft). ST may be more likely to explain socio-cognitive abilities since it is not laden with the theoretical commitments of ToM and utilizes some of the strengths of the executive control theory.

Simulation Theory holds that one’s knowledge of other minds is related to some sort of capacity to imagine or simulate the beliefs, desires and intentions of another and predict what they would do if one were to act in accordance with the simulated propositional attitudes. For Currie and Ravenscroft (2002, p. 52) each person is able to imaginatively project themselves into the place of another person and “generate within ourselves states of imagining that have as their counterparts the beliefs and desires of someone whose behavior we want to predict.” For Goldman (2006) mindreading begins with a basic “like-me” judgment based on low-level face based emotion recognition abilities. Using a basic “like-me” judgment, we can sense how others are feeling by the facial display of another. Seeing someone display the disgust face activates in our brains the same motor neuron paths as are active when we experience disgust. Through the use of special mirror-neurons, the brain is wired to fire those motor pathways it sees in others.

A main point of contention between the “theory”-theorists and the simulation theorists resides in what exactly the “like-me” consists. For the former, the judgment relies on theoretical assumptions, thus vindicating a theoretical component to social cognition; for the latter, it is the result of basic processes, neural or otherwise. The “like-me” judgment is at the heart of Goldman’s (2006) claim that simulation is the basic method through which we understand others. Regardless of what the “like-me” me judgment is or requires, the evidence for neonatal mimicry relies on studies that have proven difficult to replicate.

For both Currie and Ravenscroft (2002) and Goldman (2006) simulative abilities are fueled by a very basic perceptual ability to recognize emotions in others. In order to recognize how others are feeling, the infant must be able to cue into social stimuli. Once the infant can see these cues, they can begin to mimicking certain features of the emotional expression. Once they begin to mimic the expression, they begin to generate the affect states involved in the mimicked display. According to Currie and Ravenscroft, once these feats are accomplished the infant can assume that if the perceived creature is in a state, and the infant knows what that state feels like, whatever they feel is felt by other. The infant makes a very basic “like me” judgment and, from that judgment, an understanding of others begins. As the children begin to track eye-gaze and use proto-declarative pointing, they begin to develop more sophisticated ways of understanding that aids them in understanding and predicting the behavior of others.

There is an important difference in focus between Goldman’s and Currie and Ravnecroft’s versions of ST. For Goldman, prediction of behavior does not require a feeding in of propositional attitudes or mental states into one’s own cognitive system. In understanding another’s mental states, one mirrors those behaviors or facial expressions. In so doing, one comes to an unmediated understanding of how the other feels. For ST theorists like Currie and Ravenscroft, one places the pretend mental states into imagination and then allows the cognitive system run “offline” and generate predictions. This difference is important for theorists like Goldman who base simulation off certain neural functioning like mirroring.

Our ability to predict others’ behavior requires an act imagination to run the simulation. Our imagination provides the mental area in which we can simulate the role beliefs would play in certain inferential practices of an entertained person. If one imagines that another is hungry, then one might believe that they will go get lunch. One does this because when one believes themselves to be hungry they go get lunch. One plugs in supposed beliefs and desires and then runs a simulation as to what these states would cause them to do in that situation. Goldman (2006) allows that something like the above process occurs when we attempt to understand other’s mental states, but he thinks that this is an upper-level cognitive process and should be seen as importantly different from the lower level “like-me” judgment. The former processes require the lower level mirroring tasks.

In order for one to properly predict another’s behavior based on the simulation of another’s thoughts or behavior, certain assumptions must be made. When one simply thinks “What would I do in this situation” in order to allow the proper inferential chain to go through, one must assume that self and the target are roughly equivalent in a number of important respects. If one lacks basic assumptions about others, or for some other reasons believes that the target is different in important respects, one must augment the simulation with this information so as to have accurate predictions of the other’s behavior. One must disregard or replace certain basic assumptions that they might entertain in a normal case. Thus, the type of simulation one must perform becomes more complex.

In a typical case, one would predict that their friend, whom they know is hungry will likely attempt to go get lunch if the opportunity presents itself. One can make this judgment based on the fact that they would do the same thing in the situation. One plugs in the relevant information and runs a simulation. However, if one knows that their friend is on a diet, they have to take that into account when simulating their behavior. One cannot simply run the simulation using their own particular beliefs, as they are not on a diet. Details of this sort are crucial in understanding and predicting behavior.

On Currie and Ravenscroft’s version of ST, autism is the result of an inability to properly use imagination in the problem solving process, specifically, the process of placing ourselves, imaginatively, into the place of another. However, the problem facing persons with autism is not a complete inability to place themselves imaginatively in the situation of another. Rather, it is a difficulty in developing the skills necessary to practice the imaginative replacement.

Placing yourself in someone’s position, as detailed above, requires that you allow certain belief or desire states that you do not have to become active. We must set aside our own “mental economy” and allow the entertained propositional states to guide our beliefs of what that person might do. As with the earlier example of eating when hungry, since one is not on a diet, one must set aside their own responses and think “as if” they were. Thus, one would choose to not eat in the face of the hunger. Part of the difficulty persons with autism face is they are simply unable to make the proper adjustments to their own mental economy to allow the imagined belief states to play the proper role in simulating another’s beliefs. Persons with autism simply find it too difficult to simulate another person’s belief or desire states. Currie and Ravenscroft claim that the reason that persons with autism cannot simulate others is that they were never able to develop those abilities that allow for complex simulations to occur.

The reason persons with autism lack the development and use of ToM abilities is that they lack the “quasi-perceptual capacity for emotion recognition” (Currie and Ravenscroft, 2002 p. 159). They take the ability to recognize emotions to be something that is native or that surfaces early in development. Since persons with autism do not pick up on the basic emotional cues, they lack one of the primary inputs that allow simulation to occur. According to the authors, a young child perceives another’s emotional state, mimics those facial/bodily expressions and, based on how that mimicked facial expression feels to them as they perform it, thereby know what it feels like to be in that state. Since a person with autism does not even cue into these basic emotional states, they are never in a position to make the proper “like-me” reasoning and they never begin the basic mimicry that sets the whole simulative process into motion. The effects of this simple inability to recognize and simulate other’s emotional states are far-reaching.

Thus, autism, for Currie and Ravenscroft (2002), is an imaginative disorder. There are Executive Control problems like those mentioned in Executive Control models, but these problems come after and as a result of the inability to pick up on the basic perceptual content that cues us in to the mental states of others.

For a simulation theorist like Goldman (2006) the root of the autistic disorder is to be found in basic mirror-neuron dysfunction. Goldman bases his view off studies that show persons with autism are less apt in imitative abilities than average persons. Goldman cites further evidence that seems to indicate that the mirror neurons that allow simulation to occur are not functioning (Goldman, 2006 p. 206). The evidence for the mirror neuron dysfunction is tentative and Goldman notes this. But ST theorists find that the recent research into mirror neuron function and the role that these neurons play in a host of social behaviors such as mimicry, and thinking about others thoughts and actions are important signs that the theory is more supported than the rival “theory”-theory approach.

5. Conclusion

Autism remains an intriguing disorder that is only partially understood. No theory can claim to be the most widely accepted and each has its own difficulties. “Theory”-theory needs to find ways to deal with much of the new research on where and how certain tasks are performed in the brain. Some of this research, as Goldman (2006) notes, seems to violate the modularity basis that “theory”-theory requires. Further, the “theory”-theorists’ like Baron-Cohen have retreated from their theoretical commitments and offered alternative views of the autistic disorder (Baron-Cohen, 2002). Simulation theory and Executive Control theory often rely on the claim that the executive control abilities are dysfunctional in persons with autism and some recent research calls this into question (Ozonoff, S., and Strayer, D., 2001; Hughes, C., 2002).

Some recent research has tried to blend together the theoretical tenets of all of the approaches (Cundall, 2006; Keenan, 2000) forming a hybrid version of the theories and often a détente between “theory”-theory and simulation theory can be found. Researchers like Goldman think theoretical reasoning about other’s mental states is likely, but not the basic form of socio-cognitive thought. “Theory”-theorists often note that something like simulation is used, but it is only a later developmental ability in social cognition. Other researchers, Rittscher, et al, (2003) are avoiding some of the more theoretical disputes and have simply begun to investigate how socio-cognitive information is processed in the brain. Autism still presents any researcher interested in explaining socio-cognitive development an interesting challenge and any theory that purports to explain socio-cognitive structure and development will need to offer an explanation of the disorder.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Barkow, J., Cosmides, L., Tooby, J. (1992). The Adapted Mind. New York. Oxford University Press.
  • Baron-Cohen, S., (1995). Mindblindness. Cambridge, Mass: The MIT Press.
  • Baron-Cohen, S., (2003). The Essential Difference. New York: Basic Books.
  • Bechtel, W., and Richardson, R. (1992). Discovering Complexity. Princeton, NJ. Princeton University Press.
  • Bickle, J., (2003). Philosophy and Neurosciences: A Ruthlessly Reductive Account. Dordrecht-The Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers
  • Blake, R., Turner, L., Smoski, M, Pozdol, S., and Stone, W. (2003). Visual Recognition of Biological Motion is Impaired in children with Autism. Psychological Science, Vol. 14, 151-158.
  • Bloom, P., and German, T. (2000). Two reasons to abandon the false-belief task as a test of theory of mind. Cognition, 77: B25-B31.
  • Botterill, G., and Carruthers, P. (1999). Philosophy of Psychology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Carruthers, P., (2003). Review of Currie and Ravenscroft’s Recreative Minds. Retrieved October 25, 2004. http://ndpr.icaap.org/content/archives/2003/11/carruthers-currie.html.
  • Carruthers, P., and Smith, P. (1996). Theories of Theories of Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Castelloe, P., and Dawson, G. (1993). Subclassification of Children with Autism and Pervasive Developmental Disorders. A Questionnaire bases on the Wing and Gould Subgrouping Scheme. Journal of Autism and Developmental Disorders. Vol. 33: 229-241.
  • Ceponiene, R., Lepisto, T., Shestakova, A., Vanhala, R., Alku, P., Naatanen, R. and Yaguchi, K. (2003). Speech-sound-selective auditory impairment in children with autism: They can perceive but do not attend. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences. Vol. 100: 5567-5572.
  • Cundall, M., (2006). Autism’s Role in Understanding Social Cognition. Journal of Humanities & Social Sciences, Vol. 1, 1.
  • Currie, G., and Ravenscroft, I., (2002). Recreative Minds. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Currie, G., and Sterelny, K. (2000). How to Think about the Modularity of Mindreading. The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 50: 145-162.
  • Dawson, G., Klinger, L., Panagiotides, H., Lewy, A., and Castelloe, P. (1995). Subgroups of Autistic Children Based on Social Behavior Display Distinct Patterns of Brain Activity. Journal of Abnormal Child Psychology. Vol. 23: 569-583.
  • Fodor, J., (1980). Special Sciences, or the Disunity of Science as a Working Hypothesis. In Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology Vol. I. Ned Block Ed. Cambridge, MA. Harvard Publishers.
  • Fodor, J., (2000). The Mind Doesn’t Work That Way. Cambridge, Mass: The MIT Press.
  • Gerrans, P., (2002). The Theory of Mind Module in Evolutionary Psychology. Biology and Philosophy. Vol. 17: 305-321.
  • Goldman, A., (2006). Simulating Minds. New York. Oxford University Press.
  • Gopnik, A., and Meltzoff, A., (1998). Words, Thoughts and Theories. Cambridge, Mass: The MIT Press.
  • Harris, P. (1989). Children and Emotion. Malden, MA. Blackwell Publishers.
  • Hughes, C. (2002). Executive Functions and Development: Emerging Themes. Infant and Child Development. Vol 11: 201-209.
  • Jarrold, C., Boucher, J., and Smith, P. (1993). Symbolic Play in Autism: a review. Journal of Autism and Developmental Disorders, 23: 281-387.
  • Jarrold, C., Boucher, J., and Smith, P. (1994). Executive Function Deficits and the Pretend Play of Children with Autism. Journal of Child Psychology and Psychiatry. Vol. 35: 1473-1482.
  • Karmiloff-Smith, Annette, (1992). Beyond Modularity. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
  • Keenan, T., (2000). Mind, Memory, and Metacognition. In Minds in the Making: Essays in Honor of David R. Olson. Astington Eds. Malden MA, Blackwell Publishers.
  • Leekam, S., and Prior, M., (1994). Can Autistic Children Distinguish Lies form Jokes? A Second Look at Second Order Belief Attribution. Journal of Child Psychology and Psychiatry. Vol. 35: 901-915.
  • Leslie, A. M. (1992). Autism and the ‘theory of mind’ module. Current Directions in Psychological Science, 1: 18-21.
  • Malle, B., Moses, L., and Baldwin, D. (2001). Intentions and Intentionality: Foundations of Social Cognition. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
  • Olson, D., (1993). The Development of mental representations: the origins of mental life. Canadian Psychology, 30, 293-306.
  • Ozonoff, S., Pennington, B., and Rogers, S. (1991). Executive Function Deficits in High Functioning Autistic Individuals: Relationship to Theory of Mind. Journal of Child Psychology and Psychiatry, 32: 1081-1105.
  • Ozonoff, S., and Strayer, D. (2001). Further Evidence of Intact Working Memory in Autism. Journal of Autism and Developmental Disorders, Vol. 31: 257-263.
  • Pierce, K., Muller, R., Ambrose, J., Allen, G., and Courchesne, E. (2001). Face processing occurs outside the fusiform ‘face area’ in autists: evidence from functional MRI. Brain, 124: 2059-73.
  • Puce, A., and Perrett, D., (2003). Electrophysiology and brain imaging of biological motion. An article in, Decoding, imitating and influencing the actions of others: the mechanisms of social interaction. Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society, 358: 435-445.
  • Provine, R., (2000). Laughter: A Scientific Investigation. New York, Penguin Publishers.
  • Rittscher, J., Blake, A., Hoogs, A., Stein, G., (2003). Mathematical modeling of animate and intentional motion. An article in, Decoding, imitating and influencing the actions of others: the mechanisms of social interaction. Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society, 358: 475-490.
  • Ruffman, T., (2000). Nonverbal Theory of Mind. In Minds in the Making: Essays in Honor of David R. Olson. Astington Eds. Malden MA, Blackwell Publishers.
  • Schultz, R. T., Gauthier, I., Klin, A., Fulbright, R., Anderson, A.W., Volkmar, F., Skudlarski, P., Lacadie, C., Cohen, D. J., and Gore, J. C. (2000) Abnormal ventral temporal cortical activity among individuals with autism and Asperger syndrome during face recognition. Archives of General Psychiatry, 37: 331-340.
  • Sterelny, K., (2003). Thought in a Hostile World: The Evolution of Human Cognition. Malden, MA: Blackwell Pubishers.
  • Volkmar, F., Klin, A., Schultz, R., Chawarska, K., and Jones, W. (2003). The Social Brain in Autism. The Social Brain: Evolution and Pathology. in (Brune, Ribbert and Scheiefenhovel Eds.). Hoboken, NJ. Wiley and Sons Ltd.
  • Wellman, H. M. (1991). The Child’s Theory of Mind. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.

Author Information

Michael Cundall
Email: mcundall@astate.edu
Arkansas State University
U. S. A.

Plotinus (204—270 C.E.)

PlotinusPlotinus is considered to be the founder of Neoplatonism. Taking his lead from his reading of Plato, Plotinus developed a complex spiritual cosmology involving three foundational elements: the One, the Intelligence, and the Soul. It is from the productive unity of these three Beings that all existence emanates, according to Plotinus. The principal of emanation is not simply causal, but also contemplative. In his system, Plotinus raises intellectual contemplation to the status of a productive principle; and it is by virtue of contemplation that all existents are said to be united as a single, all-pervasive reality. In this sense, Plotinus is not a strict pantheist, yet his system does not permit the notion of creatio ex nihilo (creation out of nothingness). In addition to his cosmology, Plotinus also developed a unique theory of sense-perception and knowledge, based on the idea that the mind plays an active role in shaping or ordering the objects of its perception, rather than passively receiving the data of sense experience (in this sense, Plotinus may be said to have anticipated the phenomenological theories of Husserl). Plotinus’ doctrine that the soul is composed of a higher and a lower part — the higher part being unchangeable and divine (and aloof from the lower part, yet providing the lower part with life), while the lower part is the seat of the personality (and hence the passions and vices) — led him to neglect an ethics of the individual human being in favor of a mystical or soteric doctrine of the soul’s ascent to union with its higher part. The philosophy of Plotinus is represented in the complete collection of his treatises, collected and edited by his student Porphyry into six books of nine treatises each. For this reason they have come down to us under the title of the Enneads.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Work
  2. Metaphysics and Cosmology
    1. The One
      1. Emanation and Multiplicity
      2. Presence
    2. The Intelligence
      1. The Ideas and ‘Seminal Reasons’
      2. Being and Life
    3. The Soul
      1. Virtue
      2. Dialectic
      3. Contemplation
    4. Matter
      1. Evil
      2. Love and Happiness
      3. A Note on Nature
  3. Psychology and Epistemology
    1. The Living Being
    2. Sense-Perception and Memory
    3. Individuality and Personality
  4. Ethics
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Plotinus was born in 204 C.E. in Egypt, the exact location of which is unknown. In his mid-twenties Plotinus gravitated to Alexandria, where he attended the lectures of various philosophers, not finding satisfaction with any until he discovered the teacher Ammonius Saccas. He remained with Ammonius until 242, at which time he joined up with the Emperor Gordian on an expedition to Persia, for the purpose, it seems, of engaging the famed philosophers of that country in the pursuit of wisdom. The expedition never met its destination, for the Emperor was assassinated in Mesopotamia, and Plotinus returned to Rome to set up a school of philosophy. By this time, Plotinus had reached his fortieth year. He taught in Rome for twenty years before the arrival of Porphyry, who was destined to become his most famous pupil, as well as his biographer and editor. It was at this time that Plotinus, urged by Porphyry, began to collect his treatises into systematic form, and to compose new ones. These treatises were most likely composed from the material gathered from Plotinus’ lectures and debates with his students. The students and attendants of Plotinus’ lectures must have varied greatly in philosophical outlook and doctrine, for the Enneads are filled with refutations and corrections of the positions of Peripatetics, Stoics, Epicureans, Gnostics, and Astrologers. Although Plotinus appealed to Plato as the ultimate authority on all things philosophical, he was known to have criticized the master himself (cf. Ennead IV.8.1). We should not make the mistake of interpreting Plotinus as nothing more than a commentator on Plato, albeit a brilliant one. He was an original and profound thinker in his own right, who borrowed and re-worked all that he found useful from earlier thinkers, and even from his opponents, in order to construct the grand dialectical system presented (although in not quite systematic form) in his treatises.  The great thinker died in solitude at Campania in 270 C.E.

The Enneads are the complete treatises of Plotinus, edited by his student, Porphyry. Plotinus wrote these treatises in a crabbed and difficult Greek, and his failing eyesight rendered his penmanship oftentimes barely intelligible. We owe a great debt to Porphyry, for persisting in the patient and careful preservation of these writings. Porphyry divided the treatises of his master into six books of nine treatises each, sometimes arbitrarily dividing a longer work into several separate works in order to fulfill his numerical plan. The standard citation of the Enneads follows Porphyry’s division into book, treatise, and chapter. Hence ‘IV.8.1’ refers to book (or Ennead) four, treatise eight, chapter one.

2. Metaphysics and Cosmology

Plotinus is not a metaphysical thinker in the strict sense of the term. He is often referred to as a ‘mystical’ thinker, but even this designation fails to express the philosophical rigor of his thought. Jacques Derrida has remarked that the system of Plotinus represents the “closure of metaphysics” as well as the “transgression” of metaphysical thought itself (1973: p. 128 note). The cause for such a remark is that, in order to maintain the strict unity of his cosmology (which must be understood in the ‘spiritual’ or noetic sense, in addition to the traditional physical sense of ‘cosmos’) Plotinus emphasizes the displacement or deferral of presence, refusing to locate either the beginning (arkhe) or the end (telos) of existents at any determinate point in the ‘chain of emanations’ — the One, the Intelligence, and the Soul — that is the expression of his cosmological theory; for to predicate presence of his highest principle would imply, for Plotinus, that this principle is but another being among beings, even if it is superior to all beings by virtue of its status as their ‘begetter’. Plotinus demands that the highest principle or existent be supremely self-sufficient, disinterested, impassive, etc. However, this highest principle must still, somehow, have a part in the generation of the Cosmos. It is this tension between Plotinus’ somewhat religious demand that pure unity and self-presence be the highest form of existence in his cosmology, and the philosophical necessity of accounting for the multiplicity among existents, that animates and lends an excessive complexity and determined rigor to his thought.

Since Being and Life itself, for Plotinus, is characterized by a dialectical return to origins, a process of overcoming the ‘strictures’ of multiplicity, a theory of the primacy of contemplation (theoria) over against any traditional theories of physically causal beginnings, like what is found in the Pre-Socratic thinkers, and especially in Aristotle‘s notion of the ‘prime mover,’ becomes necessary. Plotinus proceeds by setting himself in opposition to these earlier thinkers, and comes to align himself, more or less, with the thought of Plato. However, Plotinus employs allegory in his interpretation of Plato’s Dialogues; and this leads him to a highly personal reading of the creation myth in the Timaeus (27c ff.), which serves to bolster his often excessively introspective philosophizing. Plotinus maintains that the power of the Demiurge (‘craftsman’ of the cosmos), in Plato’s myth, is derived not from any inherent creative capacity, but rather from the power of contemplation, and the creative insight it provides (see Enneads IV.8.1-2; III.8.7-8). According to Plotinus, the Demiurge does not actually create anything; what he does is govern the purely passive nature of matter, which is pure passivity itself, by imposing a sensible form (an image of the intelligible forms contained as thoughts within the mind of the Demiurge) upon it. The form (eidos) which is the arkhe or generative or productive principle of all beings, establishes its presence in the physical or sensible realm not through any act, but by virtue of the expressive contemplation of the Demiurge, who is to be identified with the Intelligence or Mind (Nous) in Plotinus’ system. Yet this Intelligence cannot be referred to as the primordial source of all existents (although it does hold the place, in Plotinus’ cosmology, of first principle), for it, itself, subsists only insofar as it contemplates a prior — this supreme prior is, according to Plotinus, the One, which is neither being nor essence, but the source, or rather, the possibility of all existence (see Ennead V.2.1). In this capacity, the One is not even a beginning, nor even an end, for it is simply the disinterested orientational ‘stanchion’ that permits all beings to recognize themselves as somehow other than a supreme ‘I’. Indeed, for Plotinus, the Soul is the ‘We’ (Ennead I.1.7), that is, the separated yet communicable likeness (homoiotai) of existents to the Mind or Intelligence that contemplates the One. This highest level of contemplation — the Intelligence contemplating the One — gives birth to the forms (eide), which serve as the referential, contemplative basis of all further existents. The simultaneous inexhaustibility of the One as a generative power, coupled with its elusive and disinterested transcendence, makes the positing of any determinate source or point of origin of existence, in the context of Plotinus’ thought, impossible. So the transgression of metaphysical thought, in Plotinus’ system, owes its achievement to his grand concept of the One.

a. The One

The ‘concept’ of the One is not, properly speaking, a concept at all, since it is never explicitly defined by Plotinus, yet it is nevertheless the foundation and grandest expression of his philosophy. Plotinus does make it clear that no words can do justice to the power of the One; even the name, ‘the One,’ is inadequate, for naming already implies discursive knowledge, and since discursive knowledge divides or separates its objects in order to make them intelligible, the One cannot be known through the process of discursive reasoning (Ennead VI.9.4). Knowledge of the One is achieved through the experience of its ‘power’ (dunamis) and its nature, which is to provide a ‘foundation’ (arkhe) and location (topos) for all existents (VI.9.6). The ‘power’ of the One is not a power in the sense of physical or even mental action; the power of the One, as Plotinus speaks of it, is to be understood as the only adequate description of the ‘manifestation’ of a supreme principle that, by its very nature, transcends all predication and discursive understanding. This ‘power,’ then, is capable of being experienced, or known, only through contemplation (theoria), or the purely intellectual ‘vision’ of the source of all things. The One transcends all beings, and is not itself a being, precisely because all beings owe their existence and subsistence to their eternal contemplation of the dynamic manifestation(s) of the One. The One can be said to be the ‘source’ of all existents only insofar as every existent naturally and (therefore) imperfectly contemplates the various aspects of the One, as they are extended throughout the cosmos, in the form of either sensible or intelligible objects or existents. The perfect contemplation of the One, however, must not be understood as a return to a primal source; for the One is not, strictly speaking, a source or a cause, but rather the eternally present possibility — or active making-possible — of all existence, of Being (V.2.1). According to Plotinus, the unmediated vision of the ‘generative power’ of the One, to which existents are led by the Intelligence (V.9.2), results in an ecstatic dance of inspiration, not in a satiated torpor (VI.9.8); for it is the nature of the One to impart fecundity to existents — that is to say: the One, in its regal, indifferent capacity as undiminishable potentiality of Being, permits both rapt contemplation and ecstatic, creative extension. These twin poles, this ‘stanchion,’ is the manifested framework of existence which the One produces, effortlessly (V.1.6). The One, itself, is best understood as the center about which the ‘stanchion,’ the framework of the cosmos, is erected (VI.9.8). This ‘stanchion’ or framework is the result of the contemplative activity of the Intelligence.

i. Emanation and Multiplicity

The One cannot, strictly speaking, be referred to as a source or a cause, since these terms imply movement or activity, and the One, being totally self-sufficient, has no need of acting in a creative capacity (VI.9.8). Yet Plotinus still maintains that the One somehow ’emanates’ or ‘radiates’ existents. This is accomplished because the One effortlessly “‘overflows’ and its excess begets an other than itself” (V.2.1, tr. O’Brien 1964) — this ‘other’ is the Intelligence (Nous), the source of the realm of multiplicity, of Being. However, the question immediately arises as to why the One, being so perfect and self-sufficient, should have any need or even any ‘ability’ to emanate or generate anything other than itself. In attempting to answer this question, Plotinus finds it necessary to appeal, not to reason, but to the non-discursive, intuitive faculty of the soul; this he does by calling for a sort of prayer, an invocation of the deity, that will permit the soul to lift itself up to the unmediated, direct, and intimate contemplation of that which exceeds it (V.1.6). When the soul is thus prepared for the acceptance of the revelation of the One, a very simple truth manifests itself: that what, from our vantage-point, may appear as an act of emanation on the part of the One, is really the effect, the necessary life-giving supplement, of the disinterested self-sufficiency that both belongs to and is the One. “In turning toward itself The One sees. It is this seeing that constitutes The Intelligence” (V.1.7, tr. O’Brien). Therefore, since the One accomplishes the generation or emanation of multiplicity, or Being, by simply persisting in its state of eternal self-presence and impassivity, it cannot be properly called a ‘first principle,’ since it is at once beyond number, and that which makes possible all number or order (cf. V.1.5).

ii. Presence

Since the One is self-sufficient, isolated by virtue of its pure self-presence, and completely impassive, it cannot properly be referred to as an ‘object’ of contemplation — not even for the Intelligence. What the Intelligence contemplates is not, properly speaking, the One Itself, but rather the generative power that emanates, effortlessly, from the One, which is beyond all Being and Essence (epikeina tes ousias) (cf. V.2.1). It has been stated above that the One cannot properly be referred to as a first principle, since it has no need to divide itself or produce a multiplicity in any manner whatsoever, since the One is purely self-contained. This leads Plotinus to posit a secondary existent or emanation of the One, the Intelligence or Mind (Nous) which is the result of the One’s direct ‘vision’ of itself (V.1.7). This allows Plotinus to maintain, within his cosmological schema, a power of pure unity or presence — the One — that is nevertheless never purely present, except as a trace in the form of the power it manifests, which is known through contemplation. Pure power and self-presence, for Plotinus, cannot reside in a being capable of generative action, for it is a main tenet of Plotinus’ system that the truly perfect existent cannot create or generate anything, since this would imply a lack on the part of that existent. Therefore, in order to account for the generation of the cosmos, Plotinus had to locate his first principle at some indeterminate point outside of the One and yet firmly united with it; this first principle, of course, is the Intelligence, which contains both unity and multiplicity, identity and difference — in other words, a self-presence that is capable of being divided into manifestable and productive forms or ‘intelligences’ (logoi spermatikoi) without, thereby, losing its unity. The reason that the Intelligence, which is the truly productive ‘first principle’ (proton arkhon) in Plotinus’ system, can generate existents and yet remain fully present to itself and at rest, is because the self-presence and nature of the Intelligence is derived from the One, which gives of itself infinitely, and without diminishing itself in any way. Furthermore, since every being or existent within Plotinus’ Cosmos owes its nature as existent to a power that is prior to it, and which it contemplates, every existent owes its being to that which stands over it, in the capacity of life-giving power. Keeping this in mind, it is difficult, if not impossible, to speak of presence in the context of Plotinus’ philosophy; rather, we must speak of varying degrees or grades of contemplation, all of which refer back to the pure trace of infinite power that is the One.

b. The Intelligence

The Intelligence (Nous) is the true first principle — the determinate, referential ‘foundation’ (arkhe) — of all existents; for it is not a self-sufficient entity like the One, but rather possesses the ability or capacity to contemplate both the One, as its prior, as well as its own thoughts, which Plotinus identifies with the Platonic Ideas or Forms (eide). The purpose or act of the Intelligence is twofold: to contemplate the ‘power’ (dunamis) of the One, which the Intelligence recognizes as its source, and to meditate upon the thoughts that are eternally present to it, and which constitute its very being. The Intelligence is distinct from the One insofar as its act is not strictly its own (or an expression of self-sufficiency as the ‘act’ of self-reflection is for the One) but rather results in the principle of order and relation that is Being — for the Intelligence and Being are identical (V.9.8). The Intelligence may be understood as the storehouse of potential being(s), but only if every potential being is also recognized as an eternal and unchangeable thought in the Divine Mind (Nous). As Plotinus maintains, the Intelligence is an independent existent, requiring nothing outside of itself for subsistence; invoking Parmenides, Plotinus states that “to think and to be are one and the same” (V.9.5; Parmenides, fragment 3). The being of the Intelligence is its thought, and the thought of the Intelligence is Being. It is no accident that Plotinus also refers to the Intelligence as God (theos) or the Demiurge (I.1.8), for the Intelligence, by virtue of its primal duality — contemplating both the One and its own thought — is capable of acting as a determinate source and point of contemplative reference for all beings. In this sense, the Intelligence may be said to produce creative or constitutive action, which is the provenance of the Soul.

i. The Ideas and the ‘Seminal Reasons’

Since the purpose or act of the Intelligence is twofold (as described above), that which comprises the being or essence of the Intelligence must be of a similar nature. That which the Intelligence contemplates, and by virtue of which it maintains its existence, is the One in the capacity of overflowing power or impassive source. This power or effortless expression of the One, which is, in the strictest sense, the Intelligence itself, is manifested as a coherency of thoughts or perfect intellectual objects that the Intelligence contemplates eternally and fully, and by virtue of which it persists in Being — these are the Ideas (eide). The Ideas reside in the Intelligence as objects of contemplation. Plotinus states that: “No Idea is different from The Intelligence but is itself an intelligence” (V.9.8, tr. O’Brien). Without in any way impairing the unity of his concept of the Intelligence, Plotinus is able to locate both permanence and eternality, and the necessary fecundity of Being, at the level of Divinity. He accomplishes this by introducing the notion that the self-identity of each Idea, its indistinguishability from Intelligence itself, makes of each Idea at once a pure and complete existent, as well as a potentiality or ‘seed’ capable of further extending itself into actualization as an entity distinct from the Intelligence (cf. V.9.14). Borrowing the Stoic term logos spermatikos or ‘seminal reason,’ Plotinus elaborates his theory that every determinate existent is produced or generated through the contemplation by its prior of a higher source, as we have seen that the One, in viewing itself, produces the Intelligence; and so, through the contemplation of the One via the Ideas, the Intelligence produces the logoi spermatikoi (‘seminal reasons’) that will serve as the productive power or essence of the Soul, which is the active or generative principle within Being (cf. V.9.6-7).

ii. Being and Life

Being, for Plotinus, is not some abstract, amorphous pseudo-concept that is somehow pre-supposed by all thinking. In the context of Plotinus’ cosmological schema, Being is given a determined and prominent place, even if it is not given, explicitly, a definition; though he does relate it to the One, by saying that the One is not Being, but “being’s begetter” (V.2.1). Although Being does not, for Plotinus, pre-suppose thought, it does pre-suppose and make possible all ‘re-active’ or causal generation. Being is necessarily fecund — that is to say, it generates or actualizes all beings, insofar as all beings are contained, as potentialities, in the ‘rational seeds’ which are the results of the thought or contemplation of the Intelligence. Being differentiates the unified thought of the Intelligence — that is, makes it repeatable and meaningful for those existents which must proceed from the Intelligence as the Intelligence proceeds from the One. Being is the principle of relation and distinguishability amongst the Ideas, or rather, it is that rational principle which makes them logoi spermatikoi. However, Being is not simply the productive capacity of Difference; it is also the source of independence and self-sameness of all existents proceeding from the Intelligence; the productive unity accomplished through the rational or dialectical synthesis of the Dyad — of the Same (tauton) and the Different (heteron) (cf. V.1.4-5). We may best understand Being, in the context of Plotinus’ thought, by saying that it differentiates and makes indeterminate the Ideas belonging to the Intelligence, only in order to return these divided or differentiated ideas, now logoi spermatikoi, to Sameness or Unity. It is the process of returning the divided and differentiated ideas to their original place in the chain of emanation that constitutes Life or temporal existence. The existence thus produced by or through Being, and called Life, is a mode of intellectual existence characterized by discursive thought, or that manner of thinking which divides the objects of thought in order to categorize them and make them knowable through the relational process of categorization or ‘orderly differentiation’. The existents that owe their life to the process of Being are capable of knowing individual existents only as they relate to one another, and not as they relate to themselves (in the capacity of ‘self-sameness’). This is discursive knowledge, and is an imperfect image of the pure knowledge of the Intelligence, which knows all beings in their essence or ‘self-sameness’ — that is, as they are purely present to the Mind, without the articulative mediation of Difference.

c. The Soul

The power of the One, as explained above, is to provide a foundation (arkhe) and location (topos) for all existents (VI.9.6). The foundation provided by the One is the Intelligence. The location in which the cosmos takes objective shape and determinate, physical form, is the Soul (cf. IV.3.9). Since the Intelligence, through its contemplation of the One and reflection on its own contents, the Ideas (eide), is both one and many, the Soul is both contemplative and active: it contemplates the Intelligence, its prior in the ‘chain of existents,’ and also extends itself, through acting upon or actualizing its own thoughts (the logoi spermatikoi), into the darkness or indeterminacy of multiplicity or Difference (which is to be identified in this sense with Matter); and by so doing, the Soul comes to generate a separate, material cosmos that is the living image of the spiritual or noetic Cosmos contained as a unified thought within the Intelligence (cp. Plato, Timaeus 37d). The Soul, like the Intelligence, is a unified existent, in spite of its dual capacity as contemplator and actor. The purely contemplative part of the Soul, which remains in constant contact with the Intelligence, is referred to by Plotinus as the ‘higher part’ of the Soul, while that part which actively descends into the changeable (or sensible) realm in order to govern and directly craft the Cosmos, is the ‘lower part,’ which assumes a state of division as it enters, out of necessity, material bodies. It is at the level of the Soul that the drama of existence unfolds; the Soul, through coming into contact with its inferior, that is, matter or pure passivity, is temporarily corrupted, and forgets the fact that it is one of the Intelligibles, owing its existence to the Intelligence, as its prior, and ultimately, to the power of the One. It may be said that the Soul is the ‘shepherd’ or ‘cultivator’ of the logoi spermatikoi, insofar as the Soul’s task is to conduct the differentiated ideas from the state of fecund multiplicity that is Being, through the drama of Life, and at last, to return these ideas to their primal state or divine status as thoughts within the Intelligence. Plotinus, holding to his principle that one cannot act without being affected by that which one acts upon, declares that the Soul, in its lower part, undergoes the drama of existence, suffers, forgets, falls into vice, etc., while the higher part remains unaffected, and persists in governing, without flaw, the Cosmos, while ensuring that all individual, embodied souls return, eventually, to their divine and true state within the Intelligible Realm. Moreover, since every embodied soul forgets, to some extent, its origin in the Divine Realm, the drama of return consists of three distinct steps: the cultivation of Virtue, which reminds the soul of the divine Beauty; the practice of Dialectic, which instructs or informs the soul concerning its priors and the true nature of existence; and finally, Contemplation, which is the proper act and mode of existence of the soul.

i. Virtue

The Soul, in its highest part, remains essentially and eternally a being in the Divine, Intelligible Realm. Yet the lower (or active), governing part of the Soul, while remaining, in its essence, a divine being and identical to the Highest Soul, nevertheless, through its act, falls into forgetfulness of its prior, and comes to attach itself to the phenomena of the realm of change, that is, of Matter. This level at which the Soul becomes fragmented into individual, embodied souls, is Nature (phusis). Since the purpose of the soul is to maintain order in the material realm, and since the essence of the soul is one with the Highest Soul, there will necessarily persist in the material realm a type of order (doxa) that is a pale reflection of the Order (logos) persisting in the Intelligible Realm. It is this secondary or derived order (doxa) that gives rise to what Plotinus calls the “civic virtues” (aretas politikas) (I.2.1). The “civic virtues” may also be called the ‘natural virtues’ (aretas phusikas) (I.3.6), since they are attainable and recognizable by reflection upon human nature, without any explicit reference to the Divine. These ‘lesser’ virtues are possible, and attainable, even by the soul that has forgotten its origin within the Divine, for they are merely the result of the imitation of virtuous men — that is, the imitation of the Nature of the Divine Soul, as it is actualized in living existents, yet not realizing that it is such. There is nothing wrong, Plotinus tells us, with imitating noble men, but only if this imitation is understood for what it is: a preparation for the attainment of the true Virtue that is “likeness to God as far as possible” (cf. I.1.2; and Plato, Theaetetus 176b). Plotinus makes it clear that the one who possesses the civic virtues does not necessarily possess the Divine Virtue, but the one who possesses the latter will necessarily possess the former (I.2.7). Those who imitate virtuous men, for example, the heroes of old, like Achilles, and take pride in this virtue, run the risk of mistaking the merely human for the Divine, and therefore committing the sin of hubris. Furthermore, the one who mistakes the human for the Divine virtue remains firmly fixed in the realm of opinion (doxa), and is unable to rise to true knowledge of the Intelligible Realm, which is also knowledge of one’s true self. The exercise of the civic virtues makes one just, courageous, well-tempered, etc. — that is, the civic virtues result in sophrosune, or a well-ordered and cultivated mind. It is easy to see, however, that this virtue is simply the ability to remain, to an extent, unaffected by the negative intrusions upon the soul of the affections of material existence. The highest Virtue consists, on the other hand, not in a rearguard defense, as it were, against the attack of violent emotions and disruptive desires, but rather in a positively active and engaged effort to regain one’s forgotten divinity (I.2.6). The highest virtue, then, is the preparation for the exercise of Dialectic, which is the tool of divine ordering wielded by the individual soul.

ii. Dialectic

Dialectic is the tool wielded by the individual soul as it seeks to attain the unifying knowledge of the Divinity; but dialectic is not, for that matter, simply a tool. It is also the most valuable part of philosophy (I.3.5), for it places all things in an intelligible order, by and through which they may be known as they are, without the contaminating diversity characteristic of the sensible realm, which is the result of the necessary manifestation of discursive knowledge — language. We may best understand dialectic, as Plotinus conceives it, as the process of gradual extraction, from the ordered multiplicity of language, of a unifying principle conducive to contemplation. The soul accomplishes this by alternating “between synthesis and analysis until it has gone through the entire domain of the intelligible and has arrived at the principle” (I.3.4, tr. O’Brien). This is to say, on the one hand, that dialectic dissolves the tension of differentiation that makes each existent a separate entity, and therefore something existing apart from the Intelligence; and, on the other hand, that dialectic is the final flourish of discursive reasoning, which, by ‘analyzing the synthesis,’ comes to a full realization of itself as the principle of order among all that exists — that is, a recognition of the essential unity of the Soul (cf. IV.1). The individual soul accomplishes this ultimate act by placing itself in the space of thinking that is “beyond being” (epekeina tou ontos) (I.3.5). At this point, the soul is truly capable of living a life as a being that is “at one and the same time … debtor to what is above and … benefactor to what is below” (IV.8.7, tr. O’Brien). This the soul accomplishes through the purely intellectual ‘act’ of Contemplation.

iii. Contemplation

Once the individual soul has, through its own act of will — externalized through dialectic — freed itself from the influence of Being, and has arrived at a knowledge of itself as the ordering principle of the cosmos, it has united its act and its thought in one supreme ordering principle (logos) which derives its power from Contemplation (theoria). In one sense, contemplation is simply a vision of the things that are — a viewing of existence. However, for Plotinus, contemplation is the single ‘thread’ uniting all existents, for contemplation, on the part of any given individual existent, is at the same time knowledge of self, of subordinate, and of prior. Contemplation is the ‘power’ uniting the One, the Intelligence, and the Soul in a single all-productive intellectual force to which all existents owe their life. ‘Vision’ (theoria), for Plotinus, whether intellectual or physical, implies not simply possession of the viewed object in or by the mind, but also an empowerment, given by the object of vision to the one who has viewed it. Therefore, through the ‘act’ of contemplation the soul becomes capable of simultaneously knowing its prior (the source of its power, the Intelligence) and, of course, of ordering or imparting life to that which falls below the soul in the order of existence. The extent to which Plotinus identifies contemplation with a creative or vivifying act is expressed most forcefully in his comment that: “since the supreme realities devote themselves to contemplation, all other beings must aspire to it, too, because the origin of all things is their end as well” (III.8.7, tr. O’Brien). This means that even brute action is a form of contemplation, for even the most vulgar or base act has, at its base and as its cause, the impulse to contemplate the greater. Since Plotinus recognizes no strict principle of cause and effect in his cosmology, he is forced, as it were, to posit a strictly intellectual process — contemplation — as a force capable of producing the necessary tension amongst beings in order for there to be at once a sort of hierarchy and, also, a unity within the cosmos. The tension, of course, is always between knower and known, and manifests itself in the form of a ‘fall’ that is also a forgetting of source, which requires remedy. The remedy is, as we have seen, the exercise of virtue and dialectic (also, see above). For once the soul has walked the ways of discursive knowledge, and accomplished, via dialectic, the necessary unification, it (the soul) becomes the sole principle of order within the realm of changeable entities, and, through the fragile synthesis of differentiation and unity accomplished by dialectic, and actualized in contemplation, holds the cosmos together in a bond of purely intellectual dependence, as of thinker to thought. The tension that makes all of this possible is the simple presence of the pure passivity that is Matter.

d. Matter

Matter, for Plotinus, may be understood as an eternally receptive substratum (hupokeimenon), in and by which all determinate existents receive their form (cf. II.4.4). Since Matter is completely passive, it is capable of receiving any and all forms, and is therefore the principle of differentiation among existents. According to Plotinus, there are two types of Matter — the intelligible and the sensible. The intelligible type is identified as the palette upon which the various colors and hues of intelligible Being are made visible or presented, while the sensible type is the ‘space of the possible,’ the excessively fecund ‘darkness’ or depth of indeterminacy into which the soul shines its vivifying light. Matter, then, is the ground or fundament of Being, insofar as the entities within the Intelligence (the logoi spermatikoi) depend upon this defining or delimiting principle for their articulation or actualization into determinate and independent intelligences; and even in the sensible realm, where the soul achieves its ultimate end in the ‘exhaustion’ that is brute activity — the final and lowest form of contemplation (cf. III.8.2) — Matter is that which receives and, in a passive sense, ‘gives form to’ the act. Since every existent, as Plotinus tells us, must produce another, in a succession of dependence and derivation (IV.8.6) which finally ends, simultaneously, in the passivity and formlessness of Matter, and the desperation of the physical act, as opposed to purely intellectual contemplation (although, it must be noted, even brute activity is a form of contemplation, as described above), Matter, and the result of its reception of action, is not inherently evil, but is only so in relation to the soul, and the extent to which the soul becomes bound to Matter through its act (I.8.14). Plotinus also maintains, in keeping with Platonic doctrine, that any sensible thing is an image of its true and eternal counterpart in the Intelligible Realm. Therefore, the sensible matter in the cosmos is but an image of the purely intellectual Matter existing or persisting, as noetic substratum, within the Intelligence (nous). Since this is the case, the confusion into which the soul is thrown by its contact with pure passivity is not eternal or irremediable, but rather a necessary and final step in the drama of Life, for once the soul has experienced the ‘chaotic passivity’ of material existence, it will yearn ever more intensely for union with its prior, and the pure contemplation that constitutes its true existence (IV.8.5).

i. Evil

The Soul’s act, as we have seen (above), is dual — it both contemplates its prior, and acts, in a generative or, more properly, a governing capacity. For the soul that remains in contact with its prior, that is, with the highest part of the Soul, the ordering of material existence is accomplished through an effortless governing of indeterminacy, which Plotinus likens to a light shining into and illuminating a dark space (cf. I.8.14); however, for the soul that becomes sundered, through forgetfulness, from its prior, there is no longer an ordering act, but a generative or productive act — this is the beginning of physical existence, which Plotinus recognizes as nothing more than a misplaced desire for the Good (cf. III.5.1). The soul that finds its fulfillment in physical generation is the soul that has lost its power to govern its inferior while remaining in touch with the source of its power, through the act of contemplation. But that is not all: the soul that seeks its end in the means of generation and production is also the soul that becomes affected by what it has produced — this is the source of unhappiness, of hatred, indeed, of Evil (kakon). For when the soul is devoid of any referential or orientational source — any claim to rulership over matter — it becomes the slave to that over which it should rule, by divine right, as it were. And since Matter is pure impassivity, the depth or darkness capable of receiving all form and of being illuminated by the light of the soul, of reason (logos), when the soul comes under the sway of Matter, through its tragic forgetting of its source, it becomes like this substratum — it is affected by any and every emotion or event that comes its way, and all but loses its divinity. Evil, then, is at once a subjective or ‘psychic’ event, and an ontological condition, insofar as the soul is the only existent capable of experiencing evil, and is also, in its highest form, the ruler or ordering principle of the material cosmos. In spite of all this, however, Evil is not, for Plotinus, a meaningless plague upon the soul. He makes it clear that the soul, insofar as it must rule over Matter, must also take on certain characteristics of that Matter in order to subdue it (I.8.8). The onto-theological problem of the source of Evil, and any theodicy required by placing the source of Evil within the godhead, is avoided by Plotinus, for he makes it clear that Evil affects only the soul, as it carries out its ordering activity within the realm of change and decay that is the countenance of Matter. Since the soul is, necessarily, both contemplative and active, it is also capable of falling, through weakness or the ‘contradiction’ of its dual functions, into entrapment or confusion amidst the chaos of pure passivity that is Matter. Evil, however, is not irremediable, since it is merely the result of privation (the soul’s privation, through forgetfulness, of its prior); and so Evil is remedied by the soul’s experience of Love.

ii. Love and Happiness

Plotinus speaks of Love in a manner that is more ‘cosmic’ than what we normally associate with that term. Love (eros), for Plotinus, is an ontological condition, experienced by the soul that has forgotten its true status as divine governor of the material realm and now longs for its true condition. Drawing on Plato, Plotinus reminds us that Love (Eros) is the child of Poverty (Penia) and Possession (Poros) (cf. Plato, Symposium 203b-c), since the soul that has become too intimately engaged with the material realm, and has forgotten its source, is experiencing a sort of ‘poverty of being,’ and longs to possess that which it has ‘lost’. This amounts to a spiritual desire, an ‘existential longing,’ although the result of this desire is not always the ‘instant salvation’ or turnabout that Plotinus recognizes as the ideal (the epistrophe described in Ennead IV.8.4, for example); oftentimes the soul expresses its desire through physical generation or reproduction. This is, for Plotinus, but a pale and inadequate reflection or imitation of the generative power available to the soul through contemplation. Now Plotinus does not state that human affection or even carnal love is an evil in itself — it is only an evil when the soul recognizes it as the only expression or end (telos) of its desire (III.5.1). The true or noble desire or love is for pure beauty, i.e., the intelligible Beauty (noetos kalon) made known by contemplation (theoria). Since this Beauty is unchangeable, and the source of all earthly or material, i.e., mutable, beauty, the soul will find true happiness (eudaimonia) when it attains an unmediated vision (theoria) of Beauty. Once the soul attains not only perception of this beauty (which comes to it only through the senses) but true knowledge of the source of Beauty, it will recognize itself as identical with the highest Soul, and will discover that its embodiment and contact with matter was a necessary expression of the Being of the Intelligence, since, as Plotinus clearly states, as long as there is a possibility for the existence and engendering of further beings, the Soul must continue to act and bring forth existents (cf. IV.8.3-4) — even if this means a temporary lapse into evil on the part of the individual or ‘fragmented’ souls that actively shape and govern matter. However, it must be kept in mind that even the soul’s return to recognition of its true state, and the resultant happiness it experiences, are not merely episodes in the inner life of an individual existent, but rather cosmic events in themselves, insofar as the activities and experiences of the souls in the material realm contribute directly to the maintenance of the cosmos. It is the individual soul’s capacity to align itself with material existence, and through its experiences to shape and provide an image of eternity for this purely passive substance, that constitutes Nature (phusis). The soul’s turnabout or epistrophe, while being the occasion of its happiness, reached through the desire that is Love, is not to be understood as an apokatastasis or ‘restoration’ of a fragmented cosmos. Rather, we must understand this process of the Soul’s fragmentation into individual souls, its resultant experiences of evil and love, and its eventual attainment of happiness, as a necessary and eternal movement taking place at the final point of emanation of the power that is the One, manifested in the Intelligence, and activated, generatively, at the level of Soul.

iii. A Note on Nature (phusis)

One final statement must be made, before we exit this section on Plotinus’ Metaphysics and Cosmology, concerning the status of Nature in this schema. Nature, for Plotinus, is not a separate power or principle of Life that may be understood independently of the Soul and its relation to Matter. Also, since the reader of this article may find it odd that I would choose to discuss ‘Love and Happiness’ in the context of a general metaphysics, let it be stated clearly that the Highest Soul, and all the individual souls, form a single, indivisible entity, The Soul (psuche) (IV.1.1), and that all which affects the individual souls in the material realm is a direct and necessary outgrowth of the Being of the Intelligible Cosmos (I.1.8). Therefore, it follows that Nature, in Plotinus’ system, is only correctly understood when it is viewed as the result of the collective experience of each and every individual soul, which Plotinus refers to as the ‘We’ (emeis) (I.1.7) — an experience, moreover, which is the direct result of the souls fragmentation into bodies in order to govern and shape Matter. For Matter, as Plotinus tells us, is such that the divine Soul cannot enter into contact with it without taking on certain of its qualities; and since it is of the nature of the Highest Soul to remain in contemplative contact with the Intelligence, it cannot descend, as a whole, into the depths of material differentiation. So the Soul divides itself, as it were, between pure contemplation and generative or governing act — it is the movement or moment of the soul’s act that results in the differentiation of the active part of Soul into bodies. It must be understood, however, that this differentiation does not constitute a separate Soul, for as we have already seen, the nature and essence of all intelligible beings deriving from the One is twofold — for the Intelligence, it is the ability to know or contemplate the power of the One, and to reflect upon that knowledge; for the Soul it is to contemplate the Intelligence, and to give active form to the ideas derived from that contemplation. The second part of the Soul’s nature or essence involves governing Matter, and therefore becoming an entity at once contemplative and unified, and active and divided. So when Plotinus speaks of the ‘lower soul,’ he is not speaking of Nature, but rather of that ability or capacity of the Soul to be affected by its actions. Since contemplation, for Plotinus, can be both purely noetic and accomplished in repose, and ‘physical’ and carried out in a state of external effort, so reflection can be both noetic and physical or affective. Nature, then, is to be understood as the Soul reflecting upon the active or physical part of its eternal contemplation. The discussion of Plotinus’ psychological and epistemological theories, which now follows, must be read as a reflection upon the experiences of the Soul, in its capacity or state as fragmented and active unity.

3. Psychology and Epistemology

Plotinus’ contributions to the philosophical understanding of the individual psyche, of personality and sense-perception, and the essential question of how we come to know what we know, cannot be properly understood or appreciated apart from his cosmological and metaphysical theories. However, the Enneads do contain more than a few treatises and passages that deal explicitly with what we today would refer to as psychology and epistemology. Plotinus is usually spurred on in such investigations by three over-arching questions and difficulties: (1) how the immaterial soul comes to be united with a material body, (2) whether all souls are one, and (3) whether the higher part of the soul is to be held responsible for the misdeeds of the lower part. Plotinus responds to the first difficulty by employing a metaphor. The Soul, he tells us, is like an eternal and pure light whose single ray comes to be refracted through a prism; this prism is matter. The result of this refraction is that the single ray is ‘fragmented’ into various and multi-colored rays, which give the appearance of being unique and separate rays of light, but yet owe their source to the single pure ray of light that has come to illumine the formerly dark ‘prism’ of matter.

If the single ray of light were to remain the same, or rather, if it were to refuse to illuminate matter, its power would be limited. Although Plotinus insists that all souls are one by virtue of owing their being to a single source, they do become divided amongst bodies out of necessity — for that which is pure and perfectly impassive cannot unite with pure passivity (matter) and still remain itself. Therefore, the Higher Soul agrees, as it were, to illuminate matter, which has everything to gain and nothing to lose by the union, being wholly incapable of engendering anything on its own. Yet it must be remembered that for Plotinus the Higher Soul is capable of giving its light to matter without in any way becoming diminished, since the Soul owes its own being to the Intelligence which it contemplates eternally and effortlessly. The individual souls — the ‘fragmented rays of light’ — though their source is purely impassive, and hence not responsible for any misdeeds they may perform, or any misfortunes that may befalls them in their incarnation, must, themselves, take on certain characteristics of matter in order to illuminate it, or as Plotinus also says, to govern it. One of these characteristics is a certain level of passivity, or the ability to be affected by the turbulence of matter as it groans and labors under the vivifying power of the soul, as though in the pangs of childbirth (cf. Plato, Letter II. 313a). This is the beginning of the individual soul’s personality, for it is at this point that the soul is capable of experiencing such emotions like anger, fear, passion, love, etc. This individual soul now comes to be spoken of by Plotinus as if it were a separate entity by. However, it must be remembered that even the individual and unique soul, in its community (koinon) with a material body, never becomes fully divided from its eternal and unchanging source.  This union of a unique, individual soul (which owes its being to its eternal source) with a material body is called by Plotinus the living being (zoon). The living being remains, always, a contemplative being, for it owes its existence to a prior, intelligible principle; but the mode of contemplation on the part of the living being is divided into three distinct stages, rising from a lesser to a greater level of intelligible ordering. These stages are: (1) pathos, or the immediate disturbance undergone by the soul through the vicissitudes of its union with matter, (2) the moment at which the disturbance becomes an object of intelligible apprehension (antilepsis), and (3) the moment at which the intelligible object (tupon) becomes perceived through the reasoning faculty (dianoia) of the soul, and duly ordered or judged (krinein). Plotinus call this three-fold structure, in its unity, sense- perception (aisthesis).

We may best understand Plotinus’ theory of perception by describing it as a ‘creation’ of intelligible objects, or forms, from the raw material (hule) provided by the corporeal realm of sensation.  The individual souls then use these created objects as tools by which to order or govern the turbulent realm of vivified matter. The problem arises when the soul is forced to think ‘through’ or with the aid of these constructed images of the forms (eide), these ‘types’ (tupoi). This is the manner of discursive reasoning that Plotinus calls dianoia, and which consists in an act of understanding that owes its knowledge (episteme) to objects external to the mind, which the mind, through sense-perception, has come to ‘grasp’ (lepsis). Now since the objects which the mind comes to ‘grasp’ are the product of a soul that has mingled, to a certain extent, with matter, or passivity, the knowledge gained by dianoia can only be opinion (doxa). The opinion may indeed be a correct one, but if it is not subject to the judgment of the higher part of the soul, it cannot properly be called true knowledge (alethes gnosis). Furthermore, the reliance on the products of sense-perception and on dianoia may lead the soul to error and to forgetfulness of its true status as one with its source, the Higher Soul. And although even the soul that falls the furthest into error and forgetfulness is still, potentially, one with the Higher Soul, it will be subject to judgment and punishment after death, which takes the form, for Plotinus, of reincarnation. The soul’s salvation consists of bringing its mind back into line with the reasoning power (logos) of its source, which it also is — the Soul. All order in the physical cosmos proceeds from the power of the Soul, and the existence of individual souls is simply the manner in which the Soul exercises its governing power over the realm of passive nature. When the individual soul forgets this primal reality or truth — that it is the principle of order and reason in the cosmos — it will look to the products of sense-perception for its knowledge, and will ultimately allow itself to be shaped by its experiences, instead of using its experiences as tools for shaping the cosmos.

a. The Living Being

What Plotinus calls the “living being” (zoon) is what we would refer to, roughly, as the human-being, or the individual possessed of a distinct personality. This being is the product of the union of the lower or active part of the soul with a corporeal body, which is in turn presided over by the Higher Soul, in its capacity as reasoning power, imparted to all individual souls through their ceaseless contemplation of their source (I.1.5-7). The “living being,” then, may be understood as a dual nature comprising a lower or physically receptive part, which is responsible for transferring to the perceptive faculty the sensations produced in the lower or ‘irrational’ part of the soul through its contact with matter (the body), and a higher or ‘rational’ part which perceives these sensations and passes judgment on them, as it were, thereby producing that lower form of knowledge called episteme in Greek, that is contrasted with the higher knowledge, gnosis, which is the sole possession of the Higher Soul. Plotinus also refers to this dual nature as the ‘We’ (emeis), for although the individual souls are in a sense divided and differentiated through their prismatic fragmentation (cf. I.1.8, IV.3.4, and IV.9.5), they remain in contact by virtue of their communal contemplation of their prior — this is the source of their unity. One must keep in mind, however, that the individual souls and the Higher Soul are not two separate orders or types of soul, nor is the “living being” a third entity derived from them. These terms are employed by Plotinus for the sole purpose of making clear the various aspects of the Soul’s governing action, which is the final stage of emanation proceeding from the Intelligence’s contemplation of the power of the One. The “living being” occupies the lowest level of rational, contemplative existence. It is the purpose of the “living being” to govern the fluctuating nature of matter by receiving its impressions, and turning them into intelligible forms for the mind of the soul to contemplate, and make use of, in its ordering of the cosmos. Now in order to receive the impressions or sensations from material existence, the soul must take on certain characteristics of matter (I.8.8-9) — the foremost characteristic being that of passivity, or the ability to undergo disruptions in one’s being, and remain affected by these disturbances. Therefore, a part of the “living being” will, of necessity, descend too far into the material or changeable realm, and will come to unite with its opposite (that is, pure passivity) to the point that it falls away from the vivifying power of the Soul, or the reasoning principle of the ‘We.’ In order to understand how this occurs, how it is remedied, and what are the consequences for the Soul and the cosmos that it governs, a few words must be said concerning sense-perception and memory.

b. Sense-Perception and Memory

Sense-perception, as Plotinus conceives it, may be described as the production and cultivation of images (of the forms residing in the Intelligence, and contemplated by the Soul). These images aid the soul in its act of governing the passive, and for that reason disorderly, realm of matter. The soul’s experience of bodily sensation (pathos) is an experience of something alien to it, for the soul remains always what it is: an intellectual being. However, as has already been stated, in order for the soul to govern matter, it must take on certain of matter’s characteristics. The soul accomplishes this by ‘translating’ the immediate disturbances of the body — i.e., physical pain, emotional disturbances, even physical love or lust — into intelligible realties (noeta) (cf. I.1.7). These intelligible realities are then contemplated by the soul as ‘types’ (tupoi) of the true images (eidolon) ‘produced’ through the Soul’s eternal contemplation of the Intelligence, by virtue of which the cosmos persists and subsists as a living image of the eternal Cosmos that is the Intelligible Realm. The individual souls order or govern the material realm by bringing these ‘types’ before the Higher Soul in an act of judgment (krinein), which completes the movement or moment of sense-perception (aisthesis). This perception, then, is not a passive imprinting or ‘stamping’ of a sensible image upon a receptive soul; rather, it is an action of the soul, indicative of the soul’s natural, productive power (cf. IV.6.3). This ‘power’ is indistinguishable from memory (mnemes), for it involves, as it were, a recollection, on the part of the lower soul, of certain ‘innate’ ideas, by which it is able to perceive what it perceives — and most importantly, by virtue of which it is able to know what it knows. The soul falls into error only when it ‘falls in love’ with the ‘types’ of the true images it already contains, in its higher part, and mistakes these ‘types’ for realities. When this occurs, the soul will make judgments independently of its higher part, and will fall into ‘sin’ (hamartia), that is, it will ‘miss the mark’ of right governance, which is its proper nature. Since such a ‘fallen’ soul is almost a separate being (for it has ceased to fully contemplate its ‘prior,’ or higher part), it will be subject to the ‘judgment’ of the Higher Soul, and will be forced to endure a chain of incarnations in various bodies, until it finally remembers its ‘true self,’ and turns its mind back to the contemplation of its higher part, and returns to its natural state (cf. IV.8.4). This movement is necessary for the maintenance of the cosmos, since, as Plotinus tells us, “the totality of things cannot continue limited to the intelligible so long as a succession of further existents is possible; although less perfect, they necessarily are because the prior existent necessarily is” (IV.8.3, tr. O’Brien). No soul can govern matter and remain unaffected by the contact. However, Plotinus assures us that the Highest Soul remains unaffected by the fluctuations and chaotic affections of matter, for it never ceases to productively contemplate its prior — which is to say: it never leaves its proper place. It is for this reason that even the souls that ‘fall’ remain part of the unity of the ‘We,’ for despite any forgetfulness that may occur on their part, they continue to owe their persistence in being to the presence of their higher part — the Soul (cf. IV.1 and IV.2, “On the Essence of the Soul”).

c. Individuality and Personality

The individual souls that are disseminated throughout the cosmos, and the Soul that presides over the cosmos, are, according to Plotinus, an essential unity. This is not to say that he denies the unique existence of the individual soul, nor what we would call a personality. However, personality, for Plotinus, is something accrued, an addition of alien elements that come to be attached to the pure soul through its assimilative contact with matter (cf. IV.7.10, and cp. Plato, Republic 611b-612a). In other words, we may say that the personality is, for Plotinus, a by-product of the soul’s governance of matter — a governance that requires a certain degree of affectivity between the vivifying soul and its receptive substratum (hupokeimenon). The soul is not really ‘acted upon’ by matter, but rather receives from the matter it animates, certain unavoidable impulses (horme) which come to limit or bind (horos) the soul in such a way as to make of it a “particular being,” possessing the illusory quality of being distinct from its source, the Soul. Plotinus does, however, maintain that each “particular being” is the product, as it were, of an intelligence (a logos spermatikos), and that the essential quality of each ‘psychic manifestation’ is already inscribed as a thought with the cosmic Mind (Nous); yet he makes it clear that it is only the essence (ousia) of the individual soul that is of Intelligible origin (V.7.1-3). The peculiar qualities of each individual, derived from contact with matter, are discardable accruements that only serve to distort the true nature of the soul. It is for this reason that the notion of the ‘autonomy of the individual’ plays no part in the dialectical onto-theology of Plotinus. The sole purpose of the individual soul is to order the fluctuating representations of the material realm, through the proper exercise of sense-perception, and to remain, as far as is possible, in imperturbable contact with its prior. The lower part of the soul, the seat of the personality, is an unfortunate but necessary supplement to the Soul’s actualization of the ideas it contemplates. Through the soul’s ‘gift’ of determinate order to the pure passivity that is matter, this matter comes to ‘exist’ in a state of ever-changing receptivity, of chaotic malleability. This malleability is mirrored in and by the accrued ‘personality’ of the soul. When this personality is experienced as something more than a conduit between pure sense-perception and the act of judgment that makes the perception(s) intelligible, then the soul has fallen into forgetfulness. At this stage, the personality serves as a surrogate to the authentic existence provided by and through contemplation of the Soul.

4. Ethics

The highest attainment of the individual soul is, for Plotinus, “likeness to God as far as is possible” (I.2.1; cf. Plato, Theaetetus 176b). This likeness is achieved through the soul’s intimate state of contemplation of its prior — the Higher Soul — which is, in fact, the individual soul in its own purified state. Now since the Soul does not come into direct contact with matter like the ‘fragmented,’ individual souls do, the purified soul will remain aloof from the disturbances of the realm of sense (pathos) and will no longer directly govern the cosmos, but leave the direct governance to those souls that still remain enmeshed in matter (cf. VI.9.7). The lower souls that descend too far into matter are those souls which experience most forcefully the dissimilative, negative affectivity of vivified matter. It is to these souls that the experience of Evil falls. For this reason, Plotinus was unable to develop a rigorous ethical system that would account for the responsibilities and moral codes of an individual living a life amidst the fluctuating realm of the senses. According to Plotinus, the soul that has descended too far into matter needs to “merely think on essential being” in order to become reunited with its higher part (IV.8.4). This seems to constitute Plotinus’ answer to any ethical questions that may have been posed to him. In fact, Plotinus develops a radical stance vis-a-vis ethics, and the problem of human suffering. In keeping with his doctrine that the higher part of the soul remains wholly unaffected by the disturbances of the sense-realm, Plotinus declares that only the lower part of the soul suffers, is subject to passions, and vices, etc. In order to drive the point home, Plotinus makes use of a striking illustration. Invoking the ancient torture device known as the Bull of Phalaris (a hollow bronze bull in which a victim was placed; the bull was then heated until it became red hot), he tells us that only the lower part of the soul will feel the torture, while the higher part remains in repose, in contemplation (I.4.13). Although Plotinus does not explicitly say so, we may assume that the soul that has reunited with its higher part will not feel the torture at all. Since the higher part of the soul is (1) the source and true state of existence of all souls, (2) cannot be affected in any way by sensible affections, and (3) since the lower soul possesses of itself the ability to free itself from the bonds of matter, all particular questions concerning ethics and morality are subsumed, in Plotinus’ system, by the single grand doctrine of the soul’s essential imperturbability. The problems plaguing the lower soul are not, for Plotinus, serious issues for philosophy. His general attitude may be summed up by a remark made in the course of one of his discussions of ‘Providence’:

“A gang of lads, morally neglected, and in that respect inferior to the intermediate class, but in good physical training, attack and overthrow another set, trained neither physically nor morally, and make off with their food and their dainty clothes. What more is called for than a laugh?” (III.2.8, tr. MacKenna).

Of course, Plotinus was no anarchist, nor was he an advocate of violence or lawlessness. Rather, he was so concerned with the welfare and the ultimate salvation of each individual soul, that he elevated philosophy — the highest pursuit of the soul — to the level of a divine act, capable of purifying each and every soul of the tainting accruements of sensual existence. Plotinus’ last words, recorded by Porphyry, more than adequately summarize the goal of his philosophy: “Strive to bring back the god in yourselves to the God in the All” (Life of Plotinus 2).

5. References and Further Reading

  • Elmer O’Brien, S. J. (1964) tr., The Essential Plotinus: Representative Treatises From The Enneads (Hackett Publishing).
    • This fine translation of the more accessible, if not always most relevant, treatises of Plotinus serves as a valuable introduction to the work of a difficult and often obscure thinker. The Introduction by O’Brien is invaluable.
  • Plotinus, The Enneads, tr. Stephen MacKenna, with Introduction and Notes by John Dillon (Penguin Books: 1991).
    • Stephen MacKenna’s rightly famous translation of Plotinus is more interpretive than literal, and often less clear to a modern English reader than what is to be found in O’Brien’s translation. However, before delving into the original Greek of Plotinus, one would do well to familiarize oneself with the poetic lines of MacKenna. The Penguin edition, although unfortunately abridged, contains an excellent Introduction by John Dillon, as well as a fine article by Paul Henry, S. J., “The Place of Plotinus in the History of Thought.” Also included is MacKenna’s translation of Porphyry’s Life of Plotinus.
  • Plotinus, The Enneads, tr. A. H. Armstrong, including the Greek, in 7 volumes (Loeb Classical Library, Harvard-London: 1966-1968).
    • This is a readily available edition of Plotinus’ Greek text. Armstrong’s translation is quite literal, but for that reason, often less than helpful in rendering the subtleties of Plotinus’ thought. For the reader who is ready to tackle Plotinus’ difficult Greek, it is recommended that she make use of the Loeb edition in conjunction with the translations of O’Brien and MacKenna, relying only marginally on Armstrong for guidance.
  • Porphyry, Launching-Points to the Realm of Mind, tr. Kenneth Guthrie (Phanes Press: 1988). [A translation of Pros ta noeta aphorismoi]
    • This little introduction to Plotinus’ philosophy by his most famous student is highly interesting, and quite valuable for an understanding of Plotinus’ influence on later Platonists. However, as an accurate representation of Plotinus’ thought, this treatise falls short. Porphyry often develops his own unique interpretations and arguments under the guise of a commentary on Plotinus. But that is as it should be. The greatest student is often the most violently original interpreter of his master’s thought.
  • Frederick Copleston, S. J. A History of Philosophy: Volume 1, Greece and Rome, Part II (Image Books: 1962).
    • This history of philosophy is considered something of a classic in the field, and the section on Plotinus is well worth reading. However, Copleston’s analysis of Plotinus’ system represents the orthodox scholarly interpretation of Plotinus that has persisted up until the present day, with all its virtues and flaws. The account in the history book is no substitute for a careful study of Plotinus’ text, although it does provide useful pointers for the beginner.
  • Kathleen Freeman, Ancilla to the Pre-Socratic Philosophers (Harvard University Press: 1970).
    • This is a complete English translation of the Fragments in Diels, Fragmente der Vorsokratiker, the standard edition of the surviving fragments of the Pre-Socratic philosophers. The study of these fragments, especially Parmenides, Heraclitus, Empedocles, and Anaxagoras, provides an essential background for the study of Plotinus.
  • Jacques Derrida, Speech and Phenomena, tr. David B. Allison (Northwestern University Press: 1973).
    • The essay “Form and Meaning: A Note on the Phenomenology of Language,” in this edition, literally has Plotinus written all ‘oeuvre’ it.

To understand Plotinus in the fullest fashion, don’t forget to familiarize yourself with Plato’s Symposium, Phaedrus, Phaedo, the Republic, and the Letters (esp. II and VII), not to mention Aristotle, the Stoics and the Epicureans, the Hellenistic Astrologers, the Gnostics, the Hermetic Corpus, Philo and Origen.

Author Information

Edward Moore
Email: patristics@gmail.com
St. Elias School of Orthodox Theology
U. S. A.

Harold Henry Joachim (1868—1938)

Harold Henry Joachim (1868-1938) was a minor idealist philosopher working in the neo-Hegelian tradition that dominated British philosophy at the end of the nineteenth century. At the time, this tradition was divided into two main camps: personal idealism and absolute idealism. Joachim was affiliated with the latter camp, whose most prominent representative was F. H. Bradley. Although Joachim has frequently been characterized as a mere disciple and promulgator of Bradley’s views, there are instances in which Joachim parts ways with Bradley, showing himself to be an independent and original thinker. These instances will be highlighted below.

Apart from a series of extensive commentaries on individual works by Aristotle, Spinoza and Descartes and an important English translation of Aristotle’s De Generatione et Corruptione, Joachim’s most important work was The Nature of Truth (1906), in which he argued for a coherence theory of truth on the basis of his idealist metaphysics. Joachim’s theory and others like it became a principal foil for G.E. Moore and Bertrand Russell as they began to break with the neo-Hegelian (a.k.a British Idealist) tradition, and to move toward what eventually became Analytic Philosophy. This dynamic between the neo-Hegelian tradition and the emerging Analytic tradition will be illustrated below by considering Bertrand Russell’s criticisms of Joachim’s theory of truth.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. The Influence of F.H. Bradley
  3. Writings
  4. The Nature of Truth
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
      1. Books
      2. Articles
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Harold Henry Joachim (1868-1938) was born in London on 28 May 1868, the son of Henry Joachim, a wool merchant, and his wife, Ellen Margaret (née Smart). Joachim’s father had come to England from Hungary as a child. Both sides of his family were musical—his uncle was the famous violinist, Joseph Joachim, and his maternal grandfather was the organist and composer, Henry Thomas Smart—and Joachim himself was a talented violinist: talented enough to stand in occasionally for absent members of his uncle’s quartet. Early in life Joachim had thought of becoming a professional violinist, but he seems to have been too intimidated by his uncle’s reputation. As a don at Oxford, however, he played frequently, organized his own amateur quartet, and was president of the University Musical Club. Musical examples and analogies appear frequently in his philosophical writings.

Joachim was educated at Harrow School and at Balliol College, Oxford, where he studied with the neo-Hegelian philosopher, R.L. Nettleship. He gained a first in classical moderations in 1888 and in literae humaniores in 1890. In 1890 he was elected to a prize fellowship at Merton College. He lectured in moral philosophy at St. Andrews University from 1892 to 1894, returned to Balliol as a lecturer in 1894, and in 1897 became a fellow and tutor in philosophy at Merton. In 1919 he moved to New College in consequence of his appointment to the Wykeham professorship of logic, a position he held until his retirement in 1935. In 1907 he married his first cousin, Elisabeth Anna Marie Charlotte Joachim, the daughter of his famous uncle. They had two daughters and one son. Brand Blanshard, who was one of his students, described him as ‘a slender man with a mat of curly reddish hair, thick-lensed glasses, a diffident manner, and a gentle, almost deferential way of speaking’ (Blanshard, 1980, p. 19). Joachim was elected fellow of the British Academy in 1922. He died at Croyde, Devon on 30 July 1938.

2. The Influence of F.H. Bradley

Joachim was a minor philosopher working within the neo-Hegelian idealist movement which dominated British philosophy at the end of the nineteenth century (cf. the article on Analytic Philosophy, section 1). Joachim’s contributions to neo-Hegelianism came late in the day, when the movement was already in decline, and this has meant that, although his work (especially the work he did before the First World War) was taken seriously when it appeared, it did not have the lasting significance that its initial reception suggested.

In Joachim’s day, Neo-Hegelianism was divided into two broad camps: the personal idealists, like J.M.E. McTaggart, who held that reality consisted of a multiplicity of inter-related individual spirits; and the absolute idealists, led by F.H. Bradley, who held that it consisted of a single, relationless, spiritual entity, the Absolute. Joachim belonged firmly in the absolutist camp.

There is no doubt that the strongest philosophical influence on Joachim was F.H. Bradley. T.S. Eliot, one of Joachim’s students, wrote that Joachim was ‘the disciple of Bradley who was closest to the master’ (Eliot, 1964, p. 9) and this seems to have been a widely held opinion. There is, indeed, a degree of truth in this, but it should not be exaggerated. Bradley and Joachim had a long professional association: Joachim’s most productive years as a philosopher were spent at Bradley’s college, Merton, where they had neighbouring rooms. (G.R.G. Mure (1961), reported that Joachim would shut the windows when Mure started to criticize Bradley, lest the great man hear.) Nonetheless, there does not seem to have been a close personal relationship between the two philosophers, for Joachim was diffident and Bradley was overbearing. Since Bradley did no teaching, students who went to Oxford to learn Bradley’s philosophy usually ended up learning it from Joachim (who probably did a better job of teaching it than Bradley would have done, for Joachim was, by all accounts, an able teacher). After Bradley’s death, it was Joachim who edited Bradley’s Collected Essays and who was responsible for completing Bradley’s famous final essay on relations which was included in that collection. A number of letters from Bradley to Joachim have been preserved, but only one from Joachim to Bradley (Bradley 1999).

Joachim’s reputation as Bradley’s closest acolyte was a mixed blessing. On the one hand, so long as Bradley remained a force to be reckoned with in philosophy, it ensured that Joachim’s work received careful attention; but once Bradley became a figure of mainly historical interest, Joachim’s own contributions to philosophy were largely forgotten.

While there is no denying Bradley’s influence on Joachim, it should not be thought that Joachim’s own philosophical writings were merely elaborations of Bradley’s position. In particular, the widely held view that Joachim’s most important original work, The Nature of Truth (1906), was an elucidation (or at most an extension) of Bradley’s views on truth, is a mistake, and one which has led to decades of misunderstanding about the theory of truth that Bradley actually held. Joachim’s theory is plainly one that is tenable only within a broadly Bradleian metaphysics, and at the time Joachim wrote no other such theory had been elaborated in detail. Nonetheless, Joachim himself was far too careful a commentator to suggest that the coherence theory of truth he put forward in The Nature of Truth was actually held by Bradley. Moreover, when Bradley himself started writing about truth (at about the time Joachim’s book was published), he made hardly any reference to Joachim. His collection of papers on the topic, Essays on Truth and Reality, contain exactly one reference to Joachim: he says merely that Joachim’s book is ‘interesting’ and that Joachim ‘did … well to discuss once more that view [which both of them rejected] for which truth consists in copying reality’ (Bradley, 1914, p.107). This is surely a case of damning by faint praise. And it is not insignificant that Joachim’s work on Bradley’s Nachlass (his posthumously published collected papers) mentioned above was assigned to him not by Bradley himself, but by Bradley’s sister, who was his literary executor. Thus there is no indication that Bradley thought his mantle should be passed to Joachim.

And there is at least one important respect in which Joachim would have wanted to disown Bradley’s mantle. Right at the end of his posthumously published Logical Studies he ventures a fundamental criticism of Bradley’s metaphysics for not being Hegelian enough. Bradley’s Appearance and Reality ends, famously, with a chapter called ‘Ultimate Doubts’. The title might seem ironical for a chapter in which he says that ‘our conclusion is certain, and … to doubt it logically is impossible’ (Bradley 1893, p. 459), but there is one respect in which the doubt is real. While Bradley maintains that he has proven that the Absolute is a perfect system in which ‘every possible suggestion’ has its logically ordained place, yet this ‘intellectual ideal’ is impossible for us to grasp: ‘The universe in its diversity has been seen to be inexplicable…. Our system throughout its detail is incomplete’ (ibid., p. 458). In this respect, Joachim maintains, Bradley’s Absolute differs from Hegel’s, and Hegel’s is much to be preferred (Joachim 1948, pp. 284-92). In this, Joachim sides with the many neo-Hegelian critics of Bradley who objected to his generally sceptical conclusions: indeed, Bradley himself described his book as ‘a sceptical study of first principles’ (Bradley 1893, p. xii). Such scepticism was not for Joachim, though there is nothing in his entire corpus which indicates how the Absolute might, in detail, be made explicable.

3. Writings

A complete list of Joachim’s philosophical publications appears at the end of this article. Here we will survey his most significant writings.

Joachim’s most important original work in philosophy was The Nature of Truth (1906), a defence of the coherence theory of truth. Truth was also the topic of three of the six papers he published in Mind. Joachim’s views on truth will be the subject of the next section, we will forego further commentary on them here.

Apart from his work on truth, almost all his other work consisted of scholarly studies of particular works of ancient or early modern philosophers. His first book was an important commentary on Spinoza’s Ethics (1901), and he followed this with two translations and commentaries (De Lineis Insecabilibus and De Generatione et Corruptione) for W.D.Ross’s edition of Aristotle’s works in English (1908, 1922). These Aristotle translations were probably his most enduring work. His translation of De Generatione et Corruptione remains in print, having been reprinted as recently as 1999, and it was for many years the standard translation, being superseded only in 1982 by C.J.F. Williams’ translation in the Clarendon Aristotle Series.

The only other works he published in his lifetime were three papers (two on scholarly points in ancient philosophy), his inaugural lecture as Wykeham professor (a work scathingly reviewed by Russell, 1920), a book review, and a letter to the editor of Mind.

Considerably more work appeared after his death than he had published in his lifetime. The posthumous works were based upon the meticulously written out lecture courses he had given at Oxford over many years. With one exception, Logical Studies (1948), the posthumous volumes were all scholarly studies of specific works of other philosophers: a commentary on Spinoza’s Tractatus de Intellectus Emendatione (1940), a study of Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics (1951), and a study of Descartes’ Rules for the Direction of the Mind (1957). In these commentaries, Joachim was concerned primarily with an exact explication de texte, and they are renowned for their meticulous attention to detail. Stuart Hampshire (1951, pp. 9-10) said that Joachim had written two of the three ‘most careful studies of Spinoza in English’. The carefulness of their exposition makes them well-worth reading even today, though the philosophical language in which they are couched and the philosophical presuppositions underlying it belong to the largely forgotten era of late nineteenth-century idealism. While they remain valuable commentaries, their neo-Hegelian ambiance can be intrusive: there are occasions where Joachim seems to suggest that if Spinoza had been a better metaphysician he would have been Bradley.

There is no doubt that Joachim found the close reading of classic philosophical texts especially congenial. He seems to have started the practice as an undergraduate under the guidance of J.A. Smith at Balliol. His relationship with Smith was close: starting in the 1890s, they frequently worked together on the interpretation of Greek philosophical texts and from 1923 to 1935 they gave a class each week during term devoted to the reading of selected texts from Aristotle (Joseph, 1938, pp. 417-20). During the vacations, Joachim prepared for these classes with extraordinary thoroughness. Smith recalled that he was often prepared to suggest improvements to the text, especially as regards punctuation. Indeed, T.S. Eliot (1938) credited his understanding of the importance of punctuation to Joachim’s exposition of the Posterior Analytics. Rather more surprising, Eliot also said that Joachim taught that ‘one should avoid metaphor wherever a plain statement can be found’. This is surprising because Joachim’s own works, like Bradley’s, are replete with metaphors, often in places where a plain statement is imperatively demanded. Indeed, his style seems to me a serious weakness, especially in his original philosophical work. Where argument is called for, he has a tendency to rhapsodize instead.

As mentioned above, only one of Joachim’s posthumous books was a work of original philosophy. This was his Logical Studies (1948), edited by L.J. Beck from the fully written-out lectures Joachim delivered as Wykeham professor from 1927 to 1935. Although Beck in the Preface reports Joachim’s opinion that these are ‘the fullest written expression of his own philosophical opinion’, they are, frankly, disappointing. It is indeed astonishing that material like this should have been taught as logic at a major university as late as the 1930s. Although it was no doubt inevitable that the major advances in formal logic of the previous fifty years would not have featured in the lectures of Oxford’s professor of logic, it is notable that he did not cover any of the main topics of traditional logic either – topics like induction and deduction, names, propositions, inference, and modality; the sort of material to be found in W.E. Johnson’s Logic, which came out about the time Joachim took up his chair. The material Joachim covers is much more concerned with metaphysics and epistemology than with logic.

The work contains three studies. The first deals with the question ‘What is Logic?’ After a long discussion, Joachim concludes that it is ‘the Synthetic-Analysis or Analytic-Synthesis of Knowledge-or-Truth’ (1948, p. 43). It is impossible to make adequate sense of this cumbersome phrase without an extended discussion of the metaphysics of Absolute Idealism, but such a discussion falls beyond the scope of this article (see the articles on Analytic Philosophy and G.E. Moore for brief descriptions of the metaphysics of Idealism). Suffice it to say that, by ‘Synthetic-Analysis or Analytic-Synthesis’, Joachim meant a certain kind of mental activity that was simultaneously analytic and synthetic:

… it brings out, makes distinct, the items of a detail by bringing out and making distinct the modes of their connexion, the structural unity (plan) of that whole, of which they are the detail; in a word, so far as it is a two-edged discursus, analysing by synthesizing and synthesizing by analysing. (p. 38)

and that, by ‘Knowledge-or-Truth’, he meant reality and mind considered together as an internally-related whole:

It is truth … in the sense of reality disclosing itself and disclosed to mind – to any and every mind; and, being truth, it is also and eo ipso knowledge – i.e. the whole theoretical movement, the entirety of cognizant activities, wherein the mind (any and every mind qua intelligent) fulfils and expresses itself by co-operating with, and participating in, the disclosure. (p. 55)

Any greater clarity on these matters is, as already stated, impossible to achieve without a protracted discussion of Idealist metaphysics; but even with such a discussion there remain questions about the ultimate cogency of these views.

The second (and longest) study is an attack on the distinction between immediate and mediate (or, as Joachim puts it, discursive) knowledge. The bulk of the study is taken up with an attack on the notion of the given (a datum), whether derived from introspection, sense-experience or conceptual intuition, on which immediate knowledge could be founded. The final study concerns truth and falsehood, and reprises the views he set forth in The Nature of Truth. Joachim’s views on truth as presented in both of these texts will be considered in the next section.

4. The Nature of Truth

By far, Joachim’s most important contribution to philosophy was his book The Nature of Truth (1906), in which he defends a coherence theory of truth. Even so, nowadays the book is probably best known for having provoked a long response from Bertrand Russell (Russell, 1907), in which Russell set forth most of what have become the standard arguments against coherence theories of truth.

Joachim’s book had four chapters: the first was a critique of the correspondence theory of truth; the second a critique of Russell’s and Moore’s early identity theory of truth ‘as a quality of independent entities’ (see the article on G.E. Moore, section 2b); the third put forward Joachim’s own coherence theory; and the fourth dealt with the problem of error. The third part of Joachim’s Logical Studies dealt with essentially the same material in the same order, but from a slightly different point of view.

In Logical Studies Joachim approached the topic through an investigation of the nature of judgements (or propositions) as the bearers of the predicates ‘true’ and ‘false’. He first rejects, on grounds drawn mainly from the first chapter of Bradley’s Principles of Logic, the view that a proposition is a mental fact which represents an external reality (this is the sort of view that gives rise to the correspondence theory of truth). Bradley’s argument, which Joachim repeats, was that beliefs, considered purely naturalistically as mental states, could not be considered to represent or be about anything outside themselves, any more than any other natural state could.

Secondly, he attacks the view that a proposition is an objective, mind-independent complex—the view which underlies the Russell-Moore identity theory. Against the Russell-Moore view, he has two objections: first, that the theory can give no account of how the mind can access the proposition; second, that the theory is forced to postulate false propositions as having the same mind-independent complexity as true ones. There is an interesting shift of emphasis here from his treatment in The Nature of Truth. In that earlier work, Joachim emphasized the first objection and based it firmly in his neo-Hegelian doctrine of internal relations—for which he was roundly criticized by Russell (1907; see below). In Logical Studies, the doctrine of internal relations is more or less ignored, and Joachim concentrates on the strangeness of Russell’s and Moore’s propositions, especially the strangeness of false propositions.

The third view, which Joachim endorses, is the idealist view in which the judgement is, to put it entirely in his own words, ‘the ideal expansion of a fact – its self-development in the medium of the discursus which is thought, and therefore through the co-operative activity of a judging mind’. A judgement is true ‘because, and in so far as, it stands or falls with a whole system of judgements which stand or fall with it’ (Joachim, 1948, p. 262).

This account, though lacking a good deal in precision, is actually clearer than that given in The Nature of Truth, where readers are bewildered by a variety of different accounts, and are left to work out for themselves how these might be regarded as descriptions of a single concept of truth rather than of several different concepts. It is worth quoting a few of Joachim’s differing statements from The Nature of Truth, since it will give a taste of the exegetic difficulties involved in his work. In one place he says that anything is true which is ‘a “significant whole”, or a whole possessed of meaning for thought’ (Joachim 1906, p. 66). Later he says that truth is a ‘process of self-fulfilment’ and ‘a living and moving whole’ (ibid., p. 77). Again later he says that it is ‘the systematic coherence which characterizes a significant whole’ and ‘an ideally complete experience’ (ibid., p. 78).

All of this is considerably less helpful than it might be, though it does serve to introduce what can be taken as the central notion of Joachim’s theory, that of a ‘significant whole’. Unfortunately, Joachim gives two different accounts of even that central notion: on pages 76 and 78 it is ‘an organized individual experience, self-fulfilling and self-fulfilled’; on p. 66, however, ‘A “significant whole” is such that all its constituent elements reciprocally involve one another, or reciprocally determine one another’s being as contributory features in a single concrete meaning.’

This latter account is clearer and more helpful in understanding his actual view. The idea that all the elements of a significant whole ‘reciprocally involve’ one another amounts to the claim that the intrinsic properties of each part determine the intrinsic properties of all the others. It is the intrinsic properties of each element that are determined because Joachim, in common with other neo-Hegelians, subscribes to a doctrine of internal relations, according to which relations are grounded in the intrinsic properties (or ‘natures’, to use Joachim’s word) of their terms. So the relations of the various parts are determined once the intrinsic properties are.

Bertrand Russell, in his critique of Joachim’s theory, argues that Joachim’s version of the coherence theory of truth entails and is entailed by the doctrine of internal relations:

It follows at once from [the doctrine of internal relations] that the whole of reality or of truth must be a significant whole in Mr. Joachim’s sense. For each part will have a nature which exhibits its relations to every other part and to the whole; hence, if the nature of any one part were completely known, the nature of the whole and of every other part would also be completely known; while conversely, if the nature of the whole were completely known, that would involve knowledge of its relations to each part, and therefore of the relations of each part to each other part, and therefore of the nature of each part. It is also evident that, if reality or truth is a significant whole in Mr. Joachim’s sense, the axiom of internal relations must be true. Hence the axiom is equivalent to the monist theory of truth. (Russell 1907, p. 140)

Russell’s argument is swift, but, when unpacked fully, can be shown to be valid (see Griffin 2008). Russell, of course, rejects the doctrine of internal relations, which he goes on to criticize at length, but he also has several other criticisms to make of the theory which are independent of the theory of relations.

One serious problem faced by all coherence theories of truth is that of eliminating the possibility of there being two distinct significant wholes, i.e., two competing, but equally coherent, systems of propositions, for then the theory would entail that there were two incompatible sets of truths. Joachim tries to avoid this by requiring that a significant whole which constitutes truth must have ‘absolutely self-contained significance’ (Joachim 1906, p. 78); he maintains that there can be only one such significant whole, the Absolute itself.

It is hardly certain that this follows, but, even if it does, the result is still problematic. If the Absolute is the only significant whole, then only what is part of the Absolute can be true. Now, as we have seen, Joachim (at least in his late work) rejects the ineffability with which Bradley shrouded the Absolute. And yet he also rejects the possibility that the significant wholes into which we compose our actual beliefs ever coincide exactly with the Absolute. It follows then—and Joachim accepts the implication—that all our actual beliefs are false. But he holds also that they are all, also, to some degree true, since each to some degree coheres with the others. This ‘degrees of truth’ doctrine is the expected, if somewhat counter-intuitive, consequence of a coherence theory of truth: since coherence comes in degrees, so, too, must truth (Joachim, 1948, pp. 262-3). It seems, then, that all our beliefs are more or less true, according as they form significant wholes which come more or less close to coinciding with the Absolute. This is certainly an intelligible view, but ultimately it does not look like a coherence theory: truth simpliciter consists in the coincidence of belief with the Absolute, and ‘coincidence’ here looks very much like another name for correspondence; coherence is merely a measure of verisimilitude, the degree to which beliefs approach coincidence with the Absolute.

Nor is it a theory which would have Bradley’s acceptance, for Bradley’s argument for the claim that it is logically impossible to doubt his account of the Absolute, rests on the claim that any idea ‘which seems hostile to our scheme … [is] an element which really is contained within it’ (Bradley, 1893, p. 460), that the Absolute contains every possible ‘idea’. But if this is the case, then, on Joachim’s theory of truth, either all beliefs are absolutely true or else the Absolute is not absolutely coherent.

Joachim is thus faced with two problems: (i) the problem of accounting for error in a theory in which every belief is to some degree true; and (ii) the problem (as Joachim puts it, 1948, pp. 266-9) of deciding whether, given that the Absolute must be absolutely coherent, our beliefs are true because they are stages in an unending dialectical movement towards the Absolute or because they are part of the timelessly complete Absolute itself.

Joachim’s response to (i), in The Nature of Truth, is to claim that error consists in ‘an insistent belief in the completeness of my partial knowledge’ (1906, p. 144): ‘[t]he erring subject’s confident belief in the truth of his knowledge distinctively characterizes error, and converts a partial truth into falsity’ (ibid., p. 162). This is hardly satisfactory. Russell’s rebuttal is too brief and too amusing not to quote:

Now this view has one great merit, namely, that it makes error consist wholly and solely in rejection of the monistic theory of truth. As long as this theory is accepted, no judgment is an error; as soon as it is rejected, every judgment is an error…. If I affirm, with a ‘confident belief in the truth of my knowledge’, that Bishop Stubbs used to wear episcopal gaiters, that is an error; if a monistic philosopher, remembering that all finite truth is only partially true, affirms that Bishop Stubbs was hanged for murder, that is not an error. (Russell 1907, p. 135)

As regards (ii), in The Nature of Truth Joachim finds the problem insoluble: ‘We must be able to conceive the one significant whole, whose coherence is perfect truth, as a self-fulfilment, in which the finite, temporal, and contingent aspect receives its full recognition and its full solution as the manifestation of the timeless and complete’ (1906, p. 169). But ‘the demands just made cannot be completely satisfied by any metaphysical theory’ and we must recognize ‘that certain demands both must be and cannot be completely satisfied’ (p. 171). Moreover, as he goes on to point out, since the coherence theory cannot satisfy these demands, it cannot itself be coherent, and thus cannot be true (p. 176). This is a somewhat surprising end to his discussion.

In Logical Studies he is slightly, but only slightly, more sanguine. There, as we have seen, he appeals, over Bradley’s head, to the Hegelian dialectic to reconcile the timeless ideal with the temporal approximation. But how this effect is achieved he doesn’t say.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

The following list includes all Joachim’s philosophical writings.

i. Books

  • A Study of the Ethics of Spinoza (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1901).
  • The Nature of Truth (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1906).
  • De Lineis Insecabilibus (translation, with full footnotes) in The Works of Aristotle, ed. by W.D. Ross, vol. 6 (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1908.
  • Immediate Experience and Mediation. Inaugural Lecture. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1919).
  • De Generatione et Corruptione. (translation, with a few footnotes.) in The Works of Aristotle, ed. by W.D. Ross, vol. 2 (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1922).
  • Aristotle on Coming-to-be and Passing-away. A revised text of the De Generatione et Corruptione with introduction and commentary. (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1922).
  • Spinoza’s Tractatus De Intellectus Emendatione: A Commentary (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1940).
  • Logical Studies, ed. by L.J. Beck (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1948).
  • Aristotle: The Nicomachean Ethics. A Commentary, ed. by D.A. Rees (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1951).
  • Descartes’ Rules for the Direction of the Mind, ed. by Errol Harris (London: Allen and Unwin, 1957).

ii. Articles

  • 1903. ‘Aristotle’s Conception of Chemical Combination’, The Journal of Philology, vol. 29, pp. 72-86.
  • 1905. ‘“Absolute” and “Relative” Truth’, Mind, vol. 14, n.s., pp. 1-14.
  • 1907. Review of Dr. S.R.T. Ross’s edition of Aristotle’s De Sensu et Memoria. (Text and Translation, with Introduction and Commentary: Cambridge University Press, 1906.) Mind, vol. 16, n.s., pp. 266-71.
  • 1907. ‘A Reply to Mr. Moore’, Mind, vol. 16, n.s., pp. 410-15.
  • 1909. ‘Psychical Process’, Mind, vol. 18, n.s., pp. 65-83.
  • 1911. ‘The Platonic Distinction between “True” and “False” Pleasures and Pains’, Philosophical Review, vol. 20, pp. 471-97.
  • 1914. ‘Some Preliminary Considerations on Self-Identity’, Mind, vol. 23, n.s., pp. 41-59.
  • 1919. ‘The “Correspondence-Notion” of Truth’, Mind, vol. 27, n.s., pp. 330-5.
  • 1920. ‘The Meaning of “Meaning”’ (Symposium), Mind, vol. 29, n.s., pp. 385-414.
  • 1927. ‘The Attempt to conceive the Absolute as a Spiritual Life’, The Journal of Philosophical Studies, vol. 2, pp. 137-52.
  • 1931. ‘“Concrete” and “Abstract” Identity’ (Letter), Mind, vol. 40, n.s., p. 533.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Blanshard, Brand (1980), ‘Autobiography’, in P.A. Schilpp (ed.), The Philosophy of Brand Blanshard (Chicago: Open Court), pp. 2-185.
  • Bradley, F.H. 1893, Appearance and Reality. A Metaphysical Essay (Oxford: Oxford University Press; 2nd edn., 9th impression, 1930).
    • The work which most strongly influenced Joachim’s philosophy.
  • Bradley, F.H. (1914), Essays on Truth and Reality (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
  • Bradley, F.H. (1999) The Collected Works of F.H. Bradley, vols. 4 and 5, ed. by Carol A. Keene (Bristol: Thoemmes)
  • Contains Bradley’s letters to Joachim, but only one of Joachim’s to Bradley.
  • Connelly, James and Rabin, Paul (1996), ‘The Correspondence between Bertrand Russell and Harold Joachim’, Bradley Studies, 2, pp. 131-60.
    • Transcribes most of the extant correspondence between Joachim and Russell; most of it connected with the theory of truth.
  • Eliot, T.S. (1938), ‘Prof. H.H. Joachim’ The Times, 4 August 1938.
  • Eliot, T.S. (1964), ‘Preface’ to Eliot, Knowledge and Experience in the Philosophy of F.H. Bradley, (New York: Farrar, Straus).
    • This was Eliot’s Harvard doctoral dissertation completed in 1916 and written under Joachim’s supervision.
  • Eliot, T.S. (1988) The Letters of T.S. Eliot, vol. 1, 1898-1922, edited by Valerie Eliot (New York: Harcourt Brace Jovanovich).
    • Eliot’s letters from Oxford, especially to his former Harvard professor, J.H. Woods, contain much information about Joachim’s classes.
  • Griffin, Nicholas 2008, ‘Bertrand Russell and Harold Joachim’, Russell: The Journal of Bertrand Russell Studies, n.s. 27, pp.
    • A survey, biographical and philosophical, of Joachim’s relations with Russell, his most persistent critic.
  • Hampshire, Stuart (1951), Spinoza (Harmsworth: Penguin).
  • Joseph, H.W.B. (1938), ‘Harold Henry Joachim, 1868-1938’, Proceedings of the British Academy, 24 (1938), pp. 396-422.
    • The best published source for biographical information about Joachim.
  • Khatchadourian, Haig 1961, The Coherence Theory of Truth: A Critical Examination (Beirut: American University)
    • A careful critique of a number of coherence theories of truth, including Joachim’s.
  • Moore, G.E. (1907), ‘Mr. Joachim’s Nature of Truth’, Mind, n.s. 16 (1907), pp. 229-35.
    • Reply to The Nature of Truth.
  • Mure, G.R.G. (1961) ‘F.H. Bradley – Towards a Portrait’, Encounter, 16: pp. 28-35.
  • Mure, G.R.G. and Schofield, M.J. (2004), ‘Joachim, Harold Henry (1868-1938)’, Oxford Dictionary of National Biography (Oxford University Press).
  • Rabin, Paul (1997), ‘Harold Henry Joachim (1868-1938)’, presented at the Anglo-Idealism Conference, Oxford, July 1997.
    • A good compilation of biographical information about Joachim from various sources; unfortunately never published.
  • Russell, Bertrand (1906), ‘What is Truth?’, The Independent Review (June, 1906), pp. 349-53.
    • Review of Joachim’s The Nature of Truth.
  • Russell, Bertrand (1906a), ‘The Nature of Truth’, Mind, 15 (1906), pp. 528-33.
    • Reply to Joachim’s criticisms of Russell’s early identity theory of truth.
  • Russell, Bertrand, (1907) ‘The Monistic Theory of Truth’ in Russell’s Philosophical Essays (New York: Simon and Schuster, 1968; 1st edn. 1910), pp. 131-46.
    • The most important critique of Joachim’s coherence theory of truth.
  • Russell, Bertrand (1920), ‘The Wisdom of our Ancestors’, The Collected Papers of Bertrand Russell, vol. 9, Essays on Language, Mind and Matter, 1919-26, edited by John G. Slater (London: Unwin Hyman, 1988), pp. 403-6.
    • Review of Joachim’s inaugural lecture.
  • Vander Veer, Garrett L. 1970, Bradley’s Metaphysics and the Self (New Haven: Yale University Press), pp. 81-90.
    • An unusual discussion of Joachim as a critic of Bradley, based on the final pages of Logical Studies.
  • Walker, Ralph (2000), ‘Joachim on the Nature of Truth’ in W.J. Mander (ed.), Anglo-American Idealism, 1865-1927 (Westport, Ct.: Greenwood Press, 2000), pp. 183-97.
    • One of the few recent articles on Joachim’s coherence theory of truth.

Author Information

Nicholas Griffin
Email: ngriffin@mcmaster.ca
McMaster University
Canada

Internalism and Externalism in Epistemology

The internalism-externalism (I-E) debate lies near the center of contemporary discussion about epistemology. The basic idea of internalism is that justification is solely determined by factors that are internal to a person. Externalists deny this, asserting that justification depends on additional factors that are external to a person. A significant aspect of the I-E debate involves setting out exactly what counts as internal to a person.

The rise of the I-E debate coincides with the rebirth of epistemology after Edmund Gettier’s famous 1963 paper, “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” In that paper, Gettier presented several cases to show that knowledge is not identical to justified true belief. Cases of this type are referred to as “Gettier cases,” and they illustrate “the Gettier problem.” Standard Gettier cases show that one can have internally adequate justification without knowledge. The introduction of the Gettier problem to epistemology required rethinking the connection between true belief and knowledge, and the subsequent discussion generated what became the I-E debate over the nature of justification in an account of knowledge. Internalists maintained that knowledge requires justification and that the nature of this justification is completely determined by a subject’s internal states or reasons. Externalists denied at least one of these commitments: either knowledge does not require justification or the nature of justification is not completely determined by internal factors alone. On the latter view, externalists maintained that the facts that determine a belief’s justification include external facts such as whether the belief is caused by the state of affairs that makes the belief true, whether the belief is counterfactually dependent on the states of affairs that makes it true, whether the belief is produced by a reliable belief-producing process, or whether the belief is objectively likely to be true. The I-E discussion engages a wide range of epistemological issues involving the nature of rationality, the ethics of belief, and skepticism.

Table of Contents

  1. The Logic of the I-E Debate
    1. Knowledge and Justification
    2. Justification and Well-foundedness
    3. The Meaning of ‘Internal’
    4. Taking Stock
  2. Reasons for Internalism
    1. The Socratic/Cartesian project
    2. Deontology (The Ethics of Belief)
    3. Natural Judgment about Cases
      1. BonJour’s Norman case
      2. The New Evil Demon Problem
  3. Reasons for Externalism
    1. The Truth Connection
    2. Grandma, Timmy and Lassie
    3. The Scandal of Skepticism
  4. The Significance of the I-E Debate
    1. Disagreement over the Significance of the Thermometer Model
    2. Disagreement over the Guiding Conception of Justification
    3. Disagreement over Naturalism in Epistemology
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. The Logic of the I-E Debate

The simple conception of the I-E debate as a dispute over whether the facts that determine justification are all internal to a person is complicated by several factors. First, some epistemologists understand externalism as a view that knowledge does not require justification while others think it should be understood as an externalist view of justification. Second, there is an important distinction between having good reasons for one’s belief (that is, propositional justification) and basing one’s belief on the good reasons one possesses (that is, doxastic justification). This distinction matters to the nature of the internalist thesis and consequently the I-E debate itself. Third, there are two different and prominent ways of understanding what is internal to a person. This bears on the nature of the internalist thesis and externalist arguments against internalism. This section explores these complications.

a. Knowledge and Justification

The traditional analysis of knowledge is that knowledge is justified true belief. As Socrates avers in the Meno, knowledge is more than true belief. Superstitious beliefs that just turn out to be true are not instances of knowledge. In the Theatetus Socrates proposes that knowledge is true belief tied down by an account. Socrates’ proposal is the beginning of what epistemologists refer to as the justified true belief (JTB) account of knowledge. A true belief tied down by an account can be understood as a true belief for which one has adequate reasons. On the JTB account having adequate reasons turns a true belief into knowledge.

The JTB account was demolished by Gettier’s famous 1963 article. As explained in the introduction Gettier cases demonstrate that knowledge is more than justified true belief. Suppose that Smith possesses a good deal of evidence for the belief that someone in his office owns a Ford. Smith’s evidence includes such things as that Smith sees Jones drive a Ford to work every day and that Jones talks about the joys of owning a Ford. It turns out, however, that (unbeknownst to Smith) Jones is deceiving his coworkers into believing he owns a Ford. At the same time, though, someone else in Smith’s office, Brown, does own a Ford. So, Smith’s belief that someone in his office owns a Ford is both justified and true. Yet it seems to most people that Smith’s belief is not an instance of knowledge.

The Gettier problem led epistemologists to rethink the connection between knowledge and true belief. An externalist position developed that focused on causal relations or, more generally, dependency relations between one’s belief and the facts as providing the key to turning true belief into knowledge (see Armstrong 1973). It is unclear from this move alone whether externalism should be understood as the view knowledge does not require justification or that justification should be understood externally. Some externalists advocate the view that knowledge doesn’t require justification but that nonetheless justification is epistemically important (see Sosa 1991b). Other externalists hold that knowledge does require justification but that the nature of the justification is amenable to an externalist analysis (see Bergmann 2006).

A significant aspect of the issue of how one should understand externalism is whether the term ‘justification’ is a term of logic or merely a place-holder for a necessary condition for knowledge. If ‘justification’ is a term of logic then it invokes notions of consistency, inconsistency, implication, and coherence. On this conception of justification an externalist analysis of the nature of justification is implausible. However, if ‘justification’ is merely a place-holder for a condition in an account of knowledge then the nature of justification might be amenable to an externalist analysis. Externalists have defended both views. Some argue that ‘justification’ is a term of logic and so their position is best understood as the view that justification is not required for knowledge. However, other externalists have argued that ‘justification’ is not a term of logic but a term that occurs in connection with knowledge talk and so is amenable to an externalist account. Many internalists, by contrast, claim that justification is necessary for knowledge and that the notion of justification may be (partially) explicated by the concepts of consistency, implication, and coherence.

b. Justification and Well-foundedness

There is a significant difference between merely having good reasons for one’s belief that the Bears will win the Super Bowl and basing one’s belief on those reasons. Mike Ditka may have excellent reasons for believing the Bears will win; they have a superior defense and an excellent running back. Nevertheless Ditka may believe that the Bears will win based on wishful thinking. In this case it’s natural to make a distinction in one’s epistemic evaluation of Ditka’s belief. Ditka’s belief is justified because he has good reasons for it. But Ditka’s believing the claim as he does is not justified because he bases his belief on wishful thinking and not the good reasons he has. This marks the distinction between propositional and doxastic justification. Other epistemologists refer to the same distinction as that between justification and well-foundedness (see Conee & Feldman 2004).

This leads to a second area of complication in the I-E debate. Internalists claim that every condition that determines a belief’s justification is internal, but causal relations are typically not internal. Since basing one’s belief on reasons is a causal relation between one’s belief and one’s reasons, internalists should not claim that every factor that determines doxastic justification is internal (see 1c below for further discussion of this). Accordingly, internalism should be understood as a view about propositional justification. Moreover, given that one cannot know unless one bases one’s belief on good reasons this implies that internalists will understand the justification condition in an account of knowledge as composed of two parts: propositional justification and some causal condition (typically referred to as “the basing relation”). This considerably complicates the I-E debate because there’s not a straightforward disagreement between internalist and externalist views of doxastic justification, since externalists typically avoid dissecting the justification condition. Common forms of externalism build in a causal requirement to justification, for example, one’s belief that p is produced by a reliable method. Nevertheless it is important to get the nature of the internalist thesis straight and only then determine the nature of the externalist objections.

c. The Meaning of ‘Internal’

The distinction between propositional and doxastic justification allows us to bring into focus different notions of internal states. Internalism is best understood as the thesis that propositional justification, not doxastic justification, is completely determined by one’s internal states. But what are one’s internal states? One’s internal states could be one’s bodily states, one’s brain states, one’s mental states (if these are different than brain states), or one’s reflectively accessible states. The two most common ways of understanding internalism has been to take internal states as either reflectively accessible states or mental states. The former view is known as accessibilism and it has been championed by Roderick Chisholm and Laurence BonJour (see also Matthias Steup (1999)). The latter view is known as mentalism and it has been defended by Richard Feldman and Earl Conee.

On an accessibilist view every factor that determines whether one’s belief is propositionally justified is reflectively accessible. Since the causal origins of one’s beliefs are not, in general, reflectively accessible they do not determine whether one’s belief is propositionally justified. But whether or not one’s belief that p and one’s belief that q are contradictory is reflectively accessible. Since contradictory beliefs cannot both be justified one can ascertain by reflection alone whether pairs of beliefs lack this devastating epistemic property.

One should note that the above claim that the causal origins of one’s beliefs are not, in general, reflectively accessible is an anti-Cartesian claim. Arguably, Descartes thought that one could always discover the causal origins of one’s beliefs. On the Cartesian view causal relations that hold between beliefs and experiences and beliefs are reflectively accessible. Many scholars, however, believe this view is false. Stemming from Freud’s work many now think that one does not have the kind of access Descartes thought one had to the causal origins of one’s beliefs. Given this an accessibilist view about doxastic justification—that is, propositional justification + the causal origins of one’s belief—is not feasible. Accessibilists should only require that every factor that determines whether one’s belief is propositionally justified is reflectively accessible.

There are varieties of accessibilist views depending on how one unpacks what states count as reflectively accessible. Are these states that one is able to reflectively access now or states that one may access given some time? If accessibilism is not restricted to current mental states then it needs to explain where the cut off is between states that count towards determining justificatory status and those that don’t count. Richard Feldman has a helpful article on this topic in which he defends the strong thesis that it is only one’s current mental states that determine justificatory status (Feldman 2004b).

Another dimension apropos accessibilism is whether the justificatory status of one’s belief needs to be accessible as well. If it does then one’s inability to determine whether or not one’s belief that p is justified demonstrates that p is not justified for one. BonJour (1985, chapter 2), for instance, is commonly cited as defending this strong kind of accessibilism. This strong version of accessibilism is often taken to be the purest form of internalism since internalism is not uncommonly associated with a commitment to higher-order principles such as one knows that p only if one knows that one knows that p. Robert Nozick (1981, p. 281) takes internalism to be the thesis that knowledge implies knowledge of all the preconditions of knowing.

The other prominent view of internal states is that they are mental states. This view is known as mentalism (see Conee & Feldman 2004b). Mentalism, like accessibilism, is a view about propositional justification, not doxastic justification. One’s mental states completely determine the justificatory status of one’s beliefs. Mentalism is connected to accessibilism since according to the Cartesian tradition one can determine which mental states one is in by reflection alone. To the extent that mentalism is distinct from accessibilism it allows that some non-reflectively accessible mental states can determine whether one’s belief is propositionally justified.

A defender of a mentalist view needs to explain which mental states determine justificatory status. Do all mental states—hopes, fears, longings—determine propositional justification or just some mental states, such as beliefs and experiences? Moreover, a defender of mentalism needs to clarify whether both current and non-current mental states can determine justificatory status. A non-current mental state is a mental state that you do not currently host. For instance, you believed a moment ago that 186 is greater than 86 but currently you are not thinking about this.

One of the advantages of mentalism is that it upholds a clear internalist thesis—justification is determined by one’s mental states—without appealing to the problematic notion of access. Many understand the notion of access to be a thinly disguised epistemic term (see, for instance, Fumerton (1995) p. 64). To have access to some fact is just to know whether or not that fact obtains. This is problematic for an accessibilist because he analyzes justification in terms of access and then use the notion of justification to partially explicate knowledge. In short, if ‘access’ is an epistemic term then any analysis of knowledge that rests upon facts about access will be circular. The mentalist escapes this problem. One’s mental states determine justification, and one does not explicate what one’s mental states are by appeal to the problematic notion of access. However, mentalism does face the objection that since it eschews the notion of access it is not a genuine form of internalism (see Bergmann 2006 for a further examination of this issue).

d. Taking Stock

Before we press on to other issues in the I-E debate let us take stock of what has been considered. Internalism is the view that all the factors that determine propositional justification are either reflectively accessible states (that is, accessibilism) or mental states (that is, mentalism). Internalists also hold that doxastic justification, which is propositional justification and a basing requirement, is necessary for knowledge. We can think of internalism as the view that all the factors that determine justification apart from a basing requirement are internal. Let us call these justification determining factors, minus the basing requirement, the J-factors. Externalists about justification deny that the J-factors are all internal. If, however, we view externalism merely as a negative thesis then we lose sight of its distinctly philosophical motivation. Externalists’ positive views are grounded in the intuition that the natural relations between one’s beliefs and the environment matter to a belief’s justification. If, for example, a subject’s belief that there is a tiger behind the tall grass is caused by the fact that there is a tiger there this fact seems significant to determining the justificatory status of that belief, even though this fact may not be reflectively accessible to one. At a certain level of generality, externalism is best viewed as stressing the justificatory significance of dependency relations between one’s belief and the environment.

2. Reasons for Internalism

This section examines prominent reasons for internalism. I will discuss three motivations for internalism: the appeal to the Socratic/Cartesian project; the appeal to deontology; and the appeal to natural judgment about cases. These three motivations are conspicuous in arguments for internalism. After giving each reason I shall consider externalist responses.

a. The Socratic/Cartesian project

One common strategy internalists employ is to emphasize that epistemic justification requires having good reasons for one’s beliefs. As both Socrates and Descartes stressed it’s not rational to believe p without possessing a good reason for believing p. Suppose I believe that the Telecom’s stock will drastically fall tomorrow. It’s reasonable to ask why I think that’s true. Clearly it’s wrong to repeat myself, saying “I believe that’s true because it is true.” So it seems I must have a reason, distinct from my original belief, for thinking that Telecom’s stock will fall. Also I cannot appeal to the causal origins of that belief or to the reliability of the specific belief process. Those sorts of facts are beyond my ken. Whatever I can appeal to will be something I am aware of. Moreover, I can’t merely appeal to another belief, for example, Karen told me that Telecom’s stock will fall. I need a good reason for thinking that Karen is good indicator about these sorts of things. Apart from that supporting belief it’s not rational to believe that Telecom’s stock will fall. So rationality requires good reasons that indicate a belief is true. The appeal to the Socratic/Cartesian project is a way to motivate the claim that it is a basic fact that rationality requires good reasons.

This requirement conflicts with externalism since externalism allows for the possibility that one’s belief is justified even though one has no reasons for that belief. To draw out this commitment let us expand on the above example. Suppose that my belief that Telecom’s stock will fall is based on my beliefs that Karen told me so and that Karen is a reliable indicator of these things. But not every belief of mine is supported by other beliefs I have. These kinds of beliefs are called basic beliefs, beliefs that are not supported by other beliefs. Consider your belief that there’s a cube on the table. What reason do you have for this belief? It might be difficult to say. Yet internalism requires that you have some reason (typically, the content of one’s experience) that supports this belief if that belief is rational. Externalists think that that is just too tall of an order. In fact one of the early motivations for externalism was to handle the justification of basic beliefs (see Armstrong 1973). In general, externalists think that basic beliefs can be justified merely by the belief meeting some external condition. One complication with this, though, is that some externalists think a basic belief require reasons but that reasons should be understood in an externalist fashion (see Alston (1988)). I shall ignore this complication because on Alston’s analysis justification depends on factors outside one’s ken. So, to the extent that one is moved by the internalist intuition, one will think that externalism falls. It allows for justification without good reasons. One should also note that this appeal to the Socratic/Cartesian project supports accessibilism.

A related argument used to support internalism appeals to the inadequacy of externalism to answer philosophical curiosity (see Fumerton 2006). If we take up the Socratic project, then we are interested in determining whether our most basic beliefs about reality are likely to be true. It seems entirely unsatisfactory to note that if one’s beliefs meet some specified external condition then the beliefs are justified; for the natural question is whether one’s belief has met that external condition. This suggests that to the extent that we are interested in whether our beliefs are epistemically justified internalism is the only game in town. Externalist Response One early externalist response was to note that internalists focus on conditions they use to determine justificatory status but that this is conceptually distinct from conditions that actually do determine justificatory status. An adequate definition of albinos may be entirely useless for finding actual albinos (see Armstrong 1973, p. 191). In a similar manner it’s at least conceptually possible that one’s analysis of the nature of justification is not a useful tool for determining whether or not one’s beliefs are justified. What this shows is that internalists need an additional argument from the fact that we can appeal to only internal factors to determine justification to the conclusion that only internal facts determine justification.

Another early response to this internalist tactic is to argue that internalism fails to meet its own demands. Alvin Goldman (1980) presents an argument of this kind, claiming that there is no definite and acceptable set of internalistic conditions that determine what cognitive attitude a subject should have given her evidence. Goldman argues for this conclusion by supposing that there is some set of internalistic conditions and then contenting that there no acceptable way to accommodate this set of conditions within the constraints laid down by internalists. For instance, Goldman reasons that one internalistic constraint is that the correctness of these conditions be reflectively accessible. But, if the correctness of this procedure depends on its ability to get one to the truth more often than not, then since that property isn’t reflectively accessible, internalists shouldn’t understand the correctness of the procedure to consist in its ability to be a good guide to the truth. Goldman then argues that other accounts of the correctness of this procedure likewise fail. So it is not possible for internalism to meet its own severe restrictions. For a similar argument see Richard Foley (1993).

b. Deontology (The Ethics of Belief)

A prominent source of support for internalism is the allegedly deontological character of justification (see Plantinga (1993), chapter 1; this section relies heavily on Plantinga’s discussion). The language of ‘justified’ & ‘unjustified’ invokes concepts like rightness & wrongness, blameless & blameworthy, and dutifulness & neglect. Facts about justification are set in the larger context of one’s duties, obligations, and requirements. Descartes, for instance, explains that false belief arises from the improper use of one’s own will. There is a two-fold implication to this. First, if one governs one’s believing as one ought then one is justified in one’s believings. Second, if one maintains proper doxastic attitudes one will have (by and large) true beliefs. Locke, like Descartes, connects justification with duty fulfillment. Locke maintains that though one may miss truth, if one governs one’s doxastic attitudes in accord with duty then one will not miss the reward of truth (Essay, IV, xvii, 24).

The argument from the deontological character of justification to internalism proceeds as follows. Justification is a matter of fulfilling one’s intellectual duties but whether or not one has fulfilled one’s intellectual duties is entirely an internal matter. One fulfills one’s intellectual duties when one has properly taken into account the evidence one possesses. If Smith scrupulously analyzes all the relevant information about Telecom’s stock prices and draws the conclusion that Telecom’s prices will soar then Smith’s belief is justified. If it later comes to light that the information was misleading this doesn’t impugn our judgment about Smith’s belief at that time. Smith was intellectually virtuous in his believing and drew the appropriate conclusion given the evidence he possessed. In contrast if Jones is an epistemically reckless stock broker who does not study the market before he makes his judgments, but happens to hit on the true belief that Telecom’s stock prices will fall then we do not count his belief as justified since he ignored all the relevant evidence. Jones should have believed otherwise.

The cases of Smith and Jones support the claim that fulfilling one’s intellectual duty is entirely a matter of what one is able to determine by reflection alone. Both Smith and Jones are able to determine that their evidence indicates Telecom’s stock will soar. Smith appropriately believes this and Jones does not. Since externalists would require some other non-reflectively accessible condition externalism is wrong. One should note that this argument supports accessiblism, not mentalism. Externalist Response Externalists have responded to this line of argument in two ways. First, some externalists deny that facts about duties, rights, or blameworthiness are relevant to the sense of justification necessary for knowledge. Second, other externalists deny that the deontological character of justification supports accessibilism. Arguments of the first kind fall into two groups: (a) arguments that a necessary condition for rights, duties, or blameworthiness is not met with respect to belief and (b) arguments that facts about deontology are not relevant to determining epistemic facts. The most common argument for (a) is that beliefs are outside of an individual’s control, and so it does not make sense to consider an individual blameworthy for a belief. This is the issue of doxastic voluntarism. Sosa (2003) and Plantinga (1993) present arguments for (b). The basic idea in these cases is that an individual may be deeply epistemically flawed but nonetheless perfectly blameless in his or her belief. An individual may, for instance, be “hardwired” to accept as valid instances of affirming the consequent; nonetheless, a person’s belief in A on the basis of if A then B and B is not justified.

Michael Bergmann (2006, chapter 4) presents an argument of the second type that the deontological character of justification does not support accessibilism. The basic idea of Bergmann’s argument is that an appeal to the deontological character of justification only supports the requirement that the person not be aware of any reasons against the belief. It does not support the stronger requirement that the person be aware of positive reasons for the belief. Bergmann then argues the weaker requirement is consistent with externalism.

c. Natural Judgment about Cases

A different strategy to support internalism is to appeal to natural judgment about cases. I shall consider two famous thought experiments designed to elicit internalist intuitions: BonJour’s Clairvoyant cases, specifically the case of Norman (BonJour 1980) and the new evil demon problem (Lehrer & Cohen 1983 & Cohen 1984). I shall present the two cases and then offer an externalist response. As Sosa (1991a) explains the two cases are related in that each is the mirror image of the other. In the Norman case there is reliability without internal evidence while in the new evil demon problem there is internal evidence without reliability.

i. BonJour’s Norman case

In BonJour’s (1980) article he presents four clairvoyant cases to illustrate the fundamental problem with externalism. Subsequent discussion has focused mainly on the case of Norman. BonJour describes the Norman case as follows:

Norman, under certain conditions that usually obtain, is a completely reliable clairvoyant with respect to certain kinds of subject matter. He possesses no evidence or reasons of any kind for or against the general possibility of such a cognitive power, or for or against the thesis that he possesses it. One day Norman comes to believe that the President is in New York City, though he has no evidence either for or against his belief. In fact the belief is true and results from his clairvoyant power, under circumstances in which it is completely reliable. (p. 21)

Intuitively it seems that Norman’s belief is not justified. Norman doesn’t have any reasons for thinking that the President is in New York City. Norman just finds himself believing that. Were Norman to reflect on his belief he would come to see that that belief is unsupported. Yet in the situation imagined Norman’s belief is the product of a reliable process. Norman is not aware of this fact. But nonetheless on some externalist analyses Norman’s belief is justified because it is produced by a reliable process.

The Norman case is used to illustrate a general problem with externalism. Externalists hold that the justification of basic beliefs requires only that the specified external condition is met (excluding the complication with Alston’s view, mentioned above). Yet where the subject lacks any internally accessible reason for thinking the belief is true it seems irrational for the subject to maintain that belief. Rationality requires good reasons.

ii. The New Evil Demon Problem

The original evil demon problem comes from Descartes. In the Meditations Descartes entertains the possibility that he is deceived by a powerful demon in believing that (for example,) he has hands. Descartes concludes that he needs to rule out this possibility by providing good reasons for thinking that he is not deceived in this way and that he can take the evidence of his senses at face value. Most epistemologists think Descartes concedes too much by requiring that he rule out this possibility in order to know that he has hands on the basis of the evidence he possesses.

The new evil demon problem is different from Descartes’ evil demon problem. This problem does not require that one rule out the possibility of massive deception in order to have knowledge. Rather the problem is intended to illustrate the inadequacy of externalism. The new evil demon problem was originally developed against reliabilism, the view that a belief’s justification consists in the reliability of the process that produced it. The problem is that there are possible individuals with the same evidence as we possess but whose evidence is not truth indicative. For instance we can conceive of individuals that have been placed in Matrix scenarios in which their brains are stimulated to have all the same experiences we have. When we seem to see a tree, normally a tree is present. However, when these individuals in a Matrix scenario seem to see a tree, there is no tree present. Their experiences are systematically misleading. Nevertheless since they possess just the same evidence that we have, the justificatory status of their beliefs is exactly the same as ours. If our beliefs are justified then so are their beliefs, and if their beliefs are not justified then our beliefs aren’t justified. This intuition reflects the key internalist claim that two individuals that are alike mentally are alike with respect to justification. There’s no difference in justification unless there’s some relevant mental difference. Externalists are committed to denying this symmetry. Since the individuals in the Matrix world fail to meet the relevant external condition their beliefs are unjustified, but since our beliefs meet the external condition our beliefs are justified.

The Externalist Response

Both the Norman case and the new evil demon problem have led to significant modifications to externalism. At a very general level the basic externalist move is that relative to our world Norman’s belief is unjustified and an individual’s belief in the Matrix world is justified. In our world clairvoyance is not a reliable belief-forming method. A clairvoyant’s belief that, for example, today is their lucky day is not caused by the relevant fact. Furthermore, a clairvoyant’s belief is not objectively likely to be true. The externalist thinks that justification tracks these actual facts and so accordingly our judgment of Norman’s belief is that it is unjustified.

Similarly in the new evil demon problem justification tracks the actual facts. Since our perceptual beliefs meet the external condition they are justified. When we consider possible individuals with the same perceptual evidence that we have, we rightly consider their beliefs justified. Granted that their beliefs do not meet the external condition in that world, but in our world such beliefs do meet the external condition.

Alvin Goldman (1993) develops this externalist response to the Norman case. Goldman argues that Norman’s belief is not justified because relative to our list of epistemic virtues and vices clairvoyant beliefs are unjustified. Goldman argues that justification is relative to actual intellectual virtues, where the virtues are understood in a reliabilist fashion. This is a departure from Goldman’s earlier view in which the reliability of a belief forming process in a world determined the justificatory status of the belief. On that view Goldman is saddled with the consequence that Norman’s beliefs is justified and the beliefs of the people in the Matrix world are unjustified. On his (1993) view a belief’s justification is determined by the reliability of processes in our world. Goldman is not saddled with those counterintuitive results but can instead maintain the internalist’s intuition without surrendering externalism. For other instances of this relativization move see Sosa (1991a) and Bergmann (2006).

3. Reasons for Externalism

The following is an examination of three prominent reasons for externalism—the argument from the truth connection, the argument from ordinary knowledge ascriptions, and the argument from the implausibility of radical skepticism. Also included are the main internalist responses.

a. The Truth Connection

A very powerful argument for externalism is that epistemic justification is essentially connected to truth. Epistemic justification differs from prudential or moral justification. One can be prudentially justified in believing that one’s close friend is a good chap. One is prudentially justified in believing that this is true. But it’s possible that one has good epistemic reasons for withholding this belief. So one is not epistemically justified in believing one’s close friend is a good fellow. How should we account for this difference between prudential and epistemic justification? The natural response is to hold that epistemic justification implies that one’s belief is objectively likely to be true whereas prudential justification (or other non-epistemic forms of justification) does not. However, whether one’s belief is objectively likely to be true is not determined by one’s mental states or one’s reflectively accessible states. The objective likelihood of a belief given a body of evidence is a matter of the strength of correlation in the actual world between the truth of the belief and the body of evidence. If one applies some liquid to a litmus paper and it turns red then the objective likelihood that the liquid is acidic is very high. But the strong correlation between red litmus paper and acidity is not reflectively accessible. So, if epistemic justification implies that one’s belief is objectively likely to be true then justification is not determined entirely by one’s internal states.

Internalist Response

Internalists argue that the problem of the truth connection is a problem for everyone. Epistemic justification is essentially connected to the truth in a way that distinguishes it from, say, prudential justification. But it is exceedingly difficult to note exactly what this connection consists of. Internalists stress that the proposed externalist solution that epistemic justification raises a belief’s objective likelihood of truth isn’t as straightforward as it first appears. The intuition in the new evil demon problem illustrates that epistemic justification does not imply that one’s belief is objectively likely to be true. So to generate an argument against internalism from the truth connection one needs to do more than appeal to the intuition of a strong connection between justification and truth. The problem of the truth connection for internalism is an active area of research. See Lehrer & Cohen (1983) for the original discussion of this problem.

b. Grandma, Timmy and Lassie

One of the most powerful motivations for externalism is that we correctly attribute knowledge to unsophisticated persons, children, and some animals. These individuals, though, lack internalist justification. So either knowledge doesn’t require justification or justification should be understood externally. Grandma knows that she has hands even though she can not rehearse an argument for that conclusion and can not even think of anything else to defend the claim that she does have hands. Timmy knows that it’s a sunny day and Lassie knows that there’s water in the bowl. In each case it appears that the subject is justified but lacks any internally accessible reason for the belief. Reflection on these cases, and many others like them, supports the externalist central contention that internalism is too strong. Persons can know without possessing internalistic justification.

The main problem with appeal to cases like Grandma, Timmy, and Lassie is that the details of such cases are open to interpretation. Internalists argue that when the cases are properly unpacked either these are not cases of justification or there is internalist justification (see “Internalist Response” immediately below). In an attempt to strengthen the argument for externalism some externalists appeal to non-standard cases. One non-standard case is the chicken-sexer case. Chicken-sexers are individuals that possess the unique ability to reliably sort male from female chickens. As the case is described chicken-sexers do not know how they sort the chickens. They report not being able to offer the criteria they use to sort the chickens. Nonetheless they are very good at sorting chickens and their beliefs that this is a male, this is a female, etc., are justified even though they lack internalist justification.

Another non-standard case is the case of quiz-show knowledge. The case envisions a contestant, call her Sally, on a popular quiz show that gets all the answers right. When a clue is offered Sally rings in with the correct answer. She’s quite good at this. Intuitively Sally knows the answers to the clues; yet from Sally’s perspective the answers just pop into her head. Moreover, Sally may believe that she does not know the answer.

What should we say about this case? Sally is very reliable. Her answers are objectively likely to be true. We can fill out the case by stipulating her answers are caused in part by the relevant fact. She learned the answer either by direct experience with the relevant fact—she was in Tiananmen Square during the famous protests of 1989—or through a reliable informant. Yet Sally lacks any internal phenomenology usually associated with remembering an answer. The answers just seem to come out of the blue. Moreover, Sally doesn’t take herself to know the answer. Yet given her excellent track record it certainly seems right to say that Sally knows the answer. This is a problematic case for internalists because it appears that no relevant internal condition is present.

Internalist Response

The argument advanced by externalists above is a conjunction of two claims: (i) these individuals have knowledge and (ii) no internalist justification is present. In the cases of Grandma, Timmy, and Lassie one response is to deny that these individuals have knowledge, but that strikes many as incredibly implausible and too concessive to skeptical worries. A much more plausible response is to argue that an internalist justification is present. In the case of Grandma, for instance, she has experiences and memories which attest that she had hands. Though she doesn’t cite that as a reason, it is nonetheless a good reason for her to believe that she has hands. Similar points can be made with respect to Timmy and Lassie. To the extent that our judgments that Timmy and Lassie have knowledge are resilient we can find appropriate experiences that indicate the truth of their beliefs.

In the chicken-sexer case internalists respond by either denying that the subject has knowledge or claiming that there are features of the chicken-sexer’s experience that indicate the sex of the chicken. The quiz-show case is more interesting. Given the description of the case it’s difficult to find a reason available to Sally that will meet internalist strictures. The options for the internalists seem limited. Since it’s not plausible that there’s a relevant internalist justification present, internalists are saddled with the result that Sally lacks knowledge. How plausible is this result? Richard Feldman (2005a) argues that it’s not apparent from the case that (for example) Sally even believes the answer. Sally is encouraged to answer and she goes with whatever pops in her head. Moreover, Feldman observes, the contestant seems to lack any stable belief forming mechanism. Since knowledge entails belief it appears then that Sally lacks knowledge because she lacks belief. Furthermore, as another option, since Sally may take herself not to know the answer she possesses a reason that undermines her knowledge (see Feldman (2005a) for the role of higher-order knowledge to defeat object-knowledge). The upshot is that the case of quiz show knowledge is indecisive against internalism: either Sally lacks the relevant belief or she possesses a reason that defeats her knowledge.

c. The Scandal of Skepticism

Another main motivation for externalism is its alleged virtues for handling skepticism in at least some of its varieties. One powerful skeptical argument begins with the premise that we lack direct access to facts about the external world. For any experiential justification we have for believing some fact about the external world—for example, there’s a magnolia tree—it’s possible to have that same justification even though there’s no such fact. The experience one has is caused by a state of one’s brain and it is possible that science could develop a method to induce in one that brain state even though there are no magnolia trees for hundreds of miles. The skeptic continues to argue that since we lack direct access to facts about the external world we lack non-inferential knowledge (or justification) for believing those facts. The final step of the skeptic’s argument is that we do lack sufficient evidence for inferential knowledge (or inferential justification) for believing those facts. Here the skeptic argues that the evidence we possess for external world beliefs does not adequately favor commonsense over a skeptical thesis. Any appeal to experiential evidence will not decide the case against the skeptic and the skeptic is happy to enter the fray over whether commonsense beats skepticism with regard to the theoretical virtues, for example, coherence and simplicity. Berkeley, for instance, argued that commonsense decidedly lost the contest against a kind of skeptical thesis (Berkeley Three Dialogues between Hylas and Philonous).

Internalists find this kind of argument very difficult to rebut. Internalists tend to focus on the final step and argue that even though experience does not imply that skepticism is false it nevertheless makes skepticism much less probable than commonsense. This response is intuitive but it brings with it a number of controversial commitments. The ensuing debate is too complex to summarize here. The upshot though is that it is no easy task to maintain this intuitive response. Consequently externalists think they have a distinct advantage over internalism. Externalists tend to think internalism lands in skepticism but that we have good reason to suspect skepticism is false. Externalists eagerly point out that their view can handle the skeptical challenge.

Externalists typically address the skeptic’s argument by denying that lack of direct access with a fact implies lack of non-inferential knowledge (or justification). In terms of an early version of externalism—D.M. Armstrong’s causal theory (Armstrong 1973)—if one’s perceptual belief that p is caused by the fact that makes it true then one knows that p. Other externalists unpack the externalist condition differently (for example, reliability or truth-tracking), but the core idea is that a lack of direct access doesn’t preclude non-inferential knowledge. Externalists press this virtue against internalist views that are saddled with the claim that lack of direct access implies no non-inferential knowledge (or justification). Assuming that the first and final steps of the skeptical argument are good (a very controversial assumption), internalism would imply that we lack knowledge. Externalists thus see their analysis of knowledge as aligning with commonsense (and against the skeptic) that we possess lots of knowledge.

Internalist Response

One internalist response to this reason for favoring externalism is to challenge the claim that internalism lands in skepticism. Some internalists develop views that imply one does have direct access to external world facts (see entry on direct realism). Another internalist move is the abductivist response which challenges the claim that we lack inferential knowledge or justification for believing commonsense. The abductivist response gets its name from Charles Sanders Peirce’s description of abduction as a good form of inductive reasoning that differs from standard inductive inference (for example, enumerative induction—this swam is white, so is the next one, so is this one as well, …, so, the general rule that all swans are white). The abductivists argues, to put it very roughly, that commonsense is the best explanation of the available data that we possess. Accordingly, we do possess inferential justification for believing that skepticism is false.

A different response to this alleged virtue of externalism is to argue that externalism yields only a conditional response to skepticism. If externalists maintain that some external condition, E, is sufficient for non-inferential knowledge or justification then we get the result that if E then one has non-inferential knowledge. For instance, if, for example, perception is reliable then we have perceptual knowledge. But, the internalist argues, we are not able to derive the unconditional claim that we have perceptual knowledge. In order to conclude that we would have to know that E obtains, but it seems all the externalist can do is appeal to some other external condition, E1, and argue that if E1 then we know that E obtains. This strategy looks unpromising (see Stroud 1989).

4. The Significance of the I-E Debate

What is the I-E debate all about? Why has the debate garnered so much attention? This section considers several proposals about the significance of the I-E debate. Most everyone sees the I-E debate as metaepistemological. The I-E debate concerns fundamental questions about epistemology: what is nature and goals of epistemological theorizing. The three proposals I examine in this section need not be exclusive. Each proposal reflects facets of the I-E debate.

a. Disagreement over the Significance of the Thermometer Model

D.M. Armstrong introduced the “thermometer model” in epistemology as a way of grasping his externalist theory (see Armstrong 1973). The “thermometer model” compares non-inferential knowledge with a good thermometer. A good thermometer reliably indicates the temperature, that is, the temperature readings reliably indicate the actual temperature. In a similar manner non-inferential knowledge is a matter of a belief being reliably true. On the thermometer model a belief that is reliably true need not meet any internalist conditions; if the belief stands in the right relation to the truth of what is believed then the belief is an item of knowledge.

The significance of the thermometer model is whether one should understand non-inferential knowledge purely in terms of external conditions. The driving motivation behind this model is that non-inferential knowledge should be understood in just the same naturalistic sense in which one understands a good thermometer. The model aims to remove questions about non-inferential knowledge from what might be called a rationalist framework in which all forms of knowledge are explicated in terms of reasons. Given the rationalist approach to noninferential knowledge one looks for some fact, different from the original belief, that one is aware of and that makes probable (or certain) the truth of one’s belief. The thermometer model cuts to the heart of this rationalistic project.

It is not at all surprising that the thermometer model met heavy resistance. Laurence BonJour argued that stress on the thermometer model would imply that Norman knows that the president is in New York. BonJour observes that the thermometer model has us view epistemic agents merely as “cognitive thermometers”. If they reliably record the facts then they have noninferential knowledge even though from their own perspective their beliefs have little by way of positive support.

The metaepistemological issue about what to make of the thermometer model is closely related to the issue of what to make of ordinary knowledge ascriptions. It is a common practice to ascribe knowledge to individuals that are in many respects like reliable thermometers. The significant question is what to make of this fact. Do such individuals meet internalistic conditions? Are our ascriptions of knowledge correct in cases in which individuals don’t meet any internalistic conditions? These are areas of ongoing research. The issues here are discussed in the contextualism literature.

b. Disagreement over the Guiding Conception of Justification

Another way to view the I-E debate is a disagreement over the guiding conception of justification. Alvin Goldman (1980) distinguishes between the regulative and theoretical conceptions of justification. The regulative conception of justification takes as its aim to offer practical advice to cognizers in order to improve their stock of beliefs. This epistemological aim, Goldman notes, is prominent in Descartes. The theoretical conception, by contrast, aims to offer a correct analysis of justification, that is, to specify the features of beliefs that confer epistemic status. Goldman sees our interest in a theory of justification as driven by these two different conceptions.

One way of explaining the significance of the I-E debate is over the role of regulative considerations in an account of justification. The access internalist can be seen as stressing the significance of some regulative conditions for a correct account of justification. This is most clearly seen in the stress on the ethics of belief. If a subject’s belief is justified then, in some sense, the subject has regulated her doxastic conduct appropriately. Externalists, by contrast, want to draw a sharp distinction between regulative and theoretical considerations to get the result that regulative considerations do not enter into one’s account of the nature of justification.

c. Disagreement over Naturalism in Epistemology

Another proposal about the significance of the I-E debate is that it is over the issue of whether to “naturalize” epistemology (see, for instance, Fumerton 1995, p. 66). As we saw above with the “thermometer model” a thread that runs through externalist analyses is the idea that epistemic concepts—justification, evidence, and knowledge—can be understood in terms of nomological concepts. Armstrong’s account of noninferential knowledge invokes the idea of a natural relation that holds between a belief and the true state of affairs believed. When a belief stands in this natural relation to the true state of affairs believed then the belief is an instance of noninferential knowledge. Moreover this natural relation is similar to the relation between a thermometer reading and the actual temperature in a good thermometer. Other externalist analysis invoke different nomological concepts: Goldman’s (1979) account makes use of the idea of reliability; Robert Nozick’s (1981) account appeals to the idea of truth-tracking which he unpacks in terms of causal concepts; and Fred Dretske’s (1981) account makes use of a naturalistic concept of information processing.

It’s important to stress the context in which these externalist accounts arose. As we have seen the recognition that the traditional justified true belief (JTB) account of knowledge failed led epistemologists to rethink the connection between true belief and knowledge. It is widely recognized that the traditional JTB account was largely explicated within a rationalist understanding of justification. Justification, on this tradition, invoked concepts such as implication, consistency, coherence, and more broadly, reasons of which the subject was aware. The introduction of the Gettier problem led epistemologists to question whether this traditional assumption was correct. Externalist analyses attempted to explain how natural relations like causation and reliability could provide the key to understanding noninferential knowledge.

Internalists, by contrast, stress the significance of mental concepts to understanding noninferential knowledge or basic justification. These concepts need not be irreducible to physical concepts. But the key idea for internalism is that mere external facts which a subject lacks awareness of are not sufficient for analyzing epistemic concepts. As Fumerton stresses (Fumerton (1995) p. 67) the key epistemic concepts for internalist are concepts like Descartes’ clarity and distinctness, Russell’s notion of direct acquaintance, or—more elusively—Chisholm’s basic notion of more reasonable than.

There are wide ranging issues with respect to naturalism in epistemology. One main issue is whether the evidential relation is contingent or necessary. Internalism can be understood as the view that the most basic evidential relation is necessary and consequently the theory of evidence is an a priori matter. Externalism, by contrast, can be understood as affirming that evidential relations are contingent (see, for example, Nozick (1981) Chapter 3 section III).

Another issue with respect to naturalism in epistemology is its connection to naturalism in the philosophy of mind. The naturalist aims to understand the mind as a physical system. Since physical systems can be explained without invoking mental concepts a naturalist in epistemology is weary of using questionable mental concepts to elucidate the nature of epistemic concepts. Internalism in epistemology is not necessarily at odds with naturalism as a metaphysical view but the internalist’s preferred concepts tend to come from commonsense psychology rather than the natural sciences. Externalists, by contrast, tend to stress natural concepts like causation, reliability, and tracking because these set up better for a naturalist view in the philosophy of mind.

5. Conclusion

The I-E debate develops out of the ruins of the traditional justified true belief account of knowledge. As Edmund Gettier famously illustrated knowledge is more than justified true belief. Attempts to answer the Gettier problem generated the I-E debate. This debate centers on a diverse group of issues: the significance of ordinary knowledge attributions, the nature of rationality, the ethics of belief, and the role of naturalism in epistemology.

See also “Internalism and Externalism in Mind and Language.”

6. References and Further Reading

  • Alston, W. 1983. “What’s Wrong with Immediate Knowledge?” Synthese 55, 73-95.
  • Alston, W. 1986. “Internalism and Externalism in Epistemology.” Philosophical Topics 14, 179-221.
  • Alston, W. 1988. “An Internalist Externalism.” Synthese 74, 265-283.
  • Alston, W. 1995. “How to think about Reliability” Philosophical Topics 23, 1-29.
  • Alston, W. 2005. Beyond “Justification”: Dimensions of Epistemic Evaluation. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Armstrong, D.M. 1973. Belief, Truth and Knowledge. New York: Cambridge.
  • Bergmann, M. 2006. Justification without Awareness. New York: Oxford.
  • BonJour, L. 1980. “Externalist Theories of Empirical Knowledge,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 5, 53-73.
  • Reprinted in Kornblith 2001. Page references are to the Kornblith reprint.
  • BonJour, L. 1985. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Chisholm, R. 1988. “The Indispensability of Internal Justification.” Synthese 74:3, 285-296.
  • Cohen, S. 1984. “Justification and Truth.” Philosophical Studies 46, 279-295.
  • Conee, E., and R. Feldman. 2004a. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. New York: Oxford.
  • Conee, E., and R. Feldman. 2004b. “Internalism Defended” in Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. New York: Oxford, 53-82.
  • Dretske, F. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49, 1-22.
  • Dretske, F. 1981. Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Feldman, R. 2004a. “In Search of Internalism and Externalism.” The Externalist Challenge, ed. Richard Schantz. New York: Walter de Gruyter. pp. 143-156.
  • Feldman, R. 2004b. “Having Evidence.” in Conee & Feldman, Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. New York: Oxford, 219-241.
  • Feldman, R. 2005a. “Respecting the Evidence.” Philosophical Perspectives 19, 95-119.
  • Feldman, R. 2005b. “Justification is Internal.” Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. eds. Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden, MA: Blackwell. pp. 270-284.
  • Foley, R. 1993. “What Am I to Believe?” in S. Wagner and R. Warner, eds. Naturalism: A Critical Appraisal. University of Notre Dame Press, 147-162.
  • Fumerton, R. 1988. “The Internalism/Externalism Controversy.” Philosophical Perspectives 2, 443-459.
  • Fumerton, R. 1995. Metaepistemology and Skepticism. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • Fumerton, R. 2004. “Inferential Internalism and the Presuppositions of Skeptical Arguments.” in The Externalist Challenge, ed. Richard Schantz. New York: Walter de Gruyter. pp.157-167.
  • Fumerton, R. 2006. “Epistemic Internalism, Philosophical Assurance and the Skeptical Predicament.” in Knowledge and Reality: Essays in honor of Alvin Plantinga, pp. 179-191.
  • Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3
  • Goldman, A. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy 64, 357-372.
  • Goldman, A. 1979. “What is Justified Belief?” in Justification and Knowledge ed. G.S. Pappas. Dordrecht: D. Reidel. 1-23.
  • Goldman, A. 1980. “The Internalist Conception of Justification,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 5, 27-51.
  • Goldman, A. 1993. “Epistemic Folkways and Scientific Epistemology,” Philosophical Issues 3, 271-285.
  • Goldman, A. 1999. “Internalism Exposed.” Journal of Philosophy 96, 271-93.
  • Kornblith, H. 1988. “How Internal Can You Get?” Synthese 74, 313-27.
  • Kornblith, H. (Ed.) 2001. Epistemology: Internalism and Externalism. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
  • Lehrer, K. and S. Cohen. 1983. “Justification, Truth, and Coherence.” Synthese 55, 191-207.
  • Nozick, R. 1981. Philosophical Explanations. Cambridge, MA: Belknap Press.
  • Plantinga, A. 1993. Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford.
  • Sosa, E. 1991a. “Reliabilism and intellectual virtue” in Knowledge in Perspective: Selected Essays in Epistemology. New York: Cambridge University Press, 131-145.
  • Sosa, E. 1991b. “Knowledge and intellectual virtue” in Knowledge in Perspective: Selected Essays in Epistemology. New York: Cambridge University Press, 225-244.
  • Sosa and BonJour, L. 2003. Epistemic Justification: Internalism vs. Externalism, Foundations vs. Virtues. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
  • Steup, M. 1999. “A Defense of Internalism.” in The Theory of Knowledge: Classical and Contemporary Readings, 2nd ed. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 373-84.
  • Steup, M. 2001. “Epistemic Duty, Evidence, and Internality.” in Knowledge, Truth, and Duty. ed. M. Steup. New York: Oxford.
  • Stroud, B. 1989. “Understanding Human Knowledge in General,” in M. Clay and K. Lehrer, eds., Knowledge and Skepticism. Boulder: Westview Press.
  • Stroud, B. 1994. “Scepticism, ‘Externalism’, and the Goal of Epistemology,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume 68: 291-307.

Author Information

Ted Poston
Email: poston “at” jaguar1 “dot” usouthal “dot” edu
University of South Alabama
U. S. A.

Gottfried Leibniz: Causation

leibnizThe views of Leibniz (1646-1716) on causation must stand as some of the more interesting in the history of philosophy, for he consistently denied that there is any genuine causal interaction between finite substances. And yet from another perspective, he sought to integrate both old and new causal taxonomies: On the one hand, Leibniz put forth a theory of causation that would accommodate the Scientific Revolution’s increasing mathematization of nature, one according to which efficient causes played a dominant role. On the other hand, Leibniz also sought to integrate certain aspects of traditional Aristotelian causation into his philosophy. In particular, while many of Leibniz’s contemporaries were rejecting Aristotelian final causes, Leibniz insisted that the pursuit of final causes was worthwhile. Indeed, they played a crucial role in his philosophical system. The result is that Leibniz produced a system with a complex integration of both old and new––of both final and efficient causes––while simultaneously denying there was any real causal interaction between substances at the most basic level. The resulting metaphysics is sufficient to secure him a significant place in the history of the philosophy of causation, one worthy of serious attention.

In introducing his views on causation, Leibniz nearly always pivoted his theory against what he saw as its main rivals, occasionalism and physical influx theory (influxus physicus). He thought both were unacceptable, and that his own theory was the only viable option. In presenting Leibniz’s own theory, the famous “preestablished harmony,” this article follows his lead by considering, in the first section, why Leibniz deemed the competitors unacceptable. The article then discusses the details of Leibniz’s positive views on causation.

Table of Contents

  1. The Negative Stance: Leibniz against Physical Influx and Occasionalism
    1. Against Physical Influx
    2. Against Occasionalism
  2. The Positive Stance: Leibniz’s Preestablished Harmony
  3. Efficient and Final Causation
  4. Divine Conservation and Concurrence
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. The Negative Stance: Leibniz against Physical Influx and Occasionalism

When it came to introducing his theory of causation, preestablished harmony, Leibniz was fond of presenting it via an argument by elimination: he would set the argument up against its main competitors; reasoning that neither of them was intelligible and so each must be false. Consequently, since the preestablished harmony is entirely intelligible according to Leibniz, and more worthy of a divine creator, it must be the true theory of causation. The following passage from 1698, written with particular attention to mind–body causation, is typical of Leibniz’s presentation:

I have pointed out that we can imagine three systems to explain the intercourse which we find between body and soul, namely, (1) the system of mutual influence of one upon the other, which when taken in the popular sense is that of the Scholastics, and which I consider impossible, as do the Cartesians; (2) that of a perpetual supervisor who represents in the one everything which happens in the other, a little as if a man were charged with constantly synchronizing two bad clocks which are in themselves incapable of agreement –– this is the system of occasional causes; and (3) that of the natural agreement of two substances such as would exist between two very exact clocks. I find this last view fully as possible as that of a supervisor and more worthy of the author of these substances, clocks or automata. (GP IV, 520 [L 494])

This highly metaphorical passage presents Leibniz’s own view, the last of the three options, as both “possible,” and “more worthy” than its competitors of being the product of divine invention. The first view, which Leibniz refers to as the “system of mutual influence,” is also labeled by him “the theory of physical influence” (A VI, 6, 135 [NE 135]), and “the hypothesis of influx” (C 521 [L 269]), among other labels. Leibniz’s claim about this theory of causation is that it is simply impossible. The other main competitor, occasionalism (or “the system of occasional causes”) is possible according to Leibniz, but it is not worthy, and so it is at least implausible. Why did Leibniz consistently make such claims about the rival theories of causation?

a. Against Physical Influx

While the history of the influx theory is complex and often unclear, it seems to have originated in the Neoplatonic tradition and was put to work by a number of medieval Scholastic philosophers (see O’Neill, 1993). The details of the history and various formulations of the influx model need not concern us here however, for what is important is that Leibniz rejects any model of causation that involves a transmission of parts between substances, that is, a passing on of something from one substance (the cause) to another (the effect). And Leibniz uses the terminology “influx” or “influence” to refer to any model of causation that involves passing properties, or “accidents,” from one substance to another, or from one “monad”––the term for Leibnizian substances––to another. The best–known passage containing Leibniz’s rejection of this model is from Monadology 7:

There is, furthermore, no way to explain how a monad could be altered or changed in its inner make-up by some other created being. For one can transpose nothing in it, nor conceive in it any internal motion that could be excited, directed, increased, or diminished within it, as can happen in composites where there is change among the parts. Monads have no windows through which something can enter into or depart from them. Accidents cannot be detached, nor wander about outside of substances, as the sensible species of the Scholastics formerly did. And so, neither substance nor accident can enter a monad from without. (GP VI, 607f. [AG 213f.])

The Scholastic model of causation involved properties of things (“species”) leaving one substance, and entering another. Consider what happens when one looks at a red wall: one’s sensory apparatus is causally acted upon. According to the target of this passage, this involves a sensible property of the wall (a “sensible species”) entering into the mind’s sensorium. According to Leibniz, “nothing ever enters into our mind naturally from the outside” (GP IV, 607 [AG 214]). Leibniz’s message is clear enough: since substances as he conceives of them are “windowless”––that is, indivisible, partless, immaterial, soul-like entities––there is no place for anything to enter into it, or leave it. As a result, one cannot conceive of a property or part of something entering a monad and transposing its parts, for monads have no parts and thus have no portals in which to enter and exit. Given that monads have no parts or windows, it is, as we have seen Leibniz claim, impossible for this theory to be true. Hence, it is not true, according to Leibniz.

b. Against Occasionalism

It is clear that Leibniz viewed occasionalism––Malebranche’s theory of causation––as the leading contender, for he addressed it in a number of published and unpublished writings spanning the course of decades. According to occasionalism, God is the only truly causally efficacious being in the universe. According to Leibniz, Malebranche’s “strongest argument for why God alone acts” (ML 412) is roughly as follows. A true cause, for Malebranche, is one according to which there is a necessary connection between it and its effect. Since bodies cannot move themselves, it must be minds that move bodies. But since there is no necessary connection between the will of a finite mind and what it wills, it follows that the only true cause is the will of God, that is, the only will for which there is a necessary connection between it and what it wills (that is, its effects). Hence, what appear to be causally efficacious acts of will by finite beings are mere occasions for God––the only true cause––to exercise his efficacious will.

Leibniz used three arguments against occasionalism. First, he argued that occasionalism consistently violates “the great principle of physics that a body never receives a change in motion except through another body in motion that pushes it.” According to Leibniz, this principle has “been violated by all those who accept souls or other immaterial principles, including here even all of the Cartesians [such as Malebranche]” (GP VI, 541 [L 587]). In other words, Leibniz believed that occasionalism, by claiming that a material object can be put into motion by something other than another material object, namely, the occasional cause of a finite will and the true cause of the divine will, violated a fundamental principle of physics. As we shall see, Leibniz believed the preestablished harmony did not do so, since every non-initial state of a body in motion has, as a real cause, some state of a body in motion.

Second, Leibniz often argued that occasionalism involved “perpetual miracles.” Consider the following from a letter to Antoine Arnauld of 30 April 1687:

[I]f I understand clearly the opinions of the authors of occasional causes, they introduce a miracle which is no less one for being continual. For it seems to me that the concept of the miracle does not consist of rarity. … I admit that the authors of occasional causes may be able to give another definition of the term, but it seems that according to usage a miracle differs intrinsically through the substance of the act from a common action, and not by an external accident of frequent repetition, and that strictly speaking God performs a miracle whenever he exceeds the forces he has given to creatures and maintains in them. (GP II, 92f. [LA 116])

Notice that Leibniz’s objection is not simply that occasionalism is miraculous because God is constantly acting in the course of nature. Rather, his objection is that according to occasionalism, there is nothing in the nature of objects to explain how bodies behave. All change on Malebranche’s system is explained by appeal to God, and not by the natures or intrinsic forces of created things. Finite bodies on this view are merely extended hunks of matter with no nature by appeal to which one can explain motion. Thus, there is no natural explanation for natural change (no naturally inner cause of motion), and hence such change is supernatural, that is, miraculous.

Finally, this second argument is closely connected with a third argument. Throughout all of his later years, Leibniz sought to distance himself from Spinoza. His primary way of doing so was to insist that there are genuine finite substances, a claim at odds with Spinoza’s monism. According to Leibniz, the very nature of a substance consists in force, or its ability to act, for if it has no such ability, then it is a mere modification of God, the only other substance who could act. Leibniz believed that occasionalism was in danger of reducing into the view of Spinoza—a doctrine inconsistent with traditional theology, and in any event, according to Leibniz, one at odds with the common sense view that creatures are genuine individuals:

I have many other arguments to present and several of them serve to show that according to the view which completely robs created things of all power and action, God would be the only substance, and created things would be only accidents or modifications of God. So those who are of this opinion will, in spite of themselves, fall into that of Spinoza, who seems to me to have taken furthest the consequences of the Cartesian doctrine of occasional causes. (GP IV, 590 [WF 164])

Because occasionalism makes God the principle of activity in created substances, it makes God the very nature of created substances. Hence, there is only one substance (God), and created individuals are modifications of God. So, Leibniz argued that occasionalism has the dangerous consequence of collapsing into Spinozism. (For considerations of Leibniz’ treatments of occasionalism, see Rutherford, 1993; Sleigh 1990.)

2. The Positive Stance: Leibniz’s Preestablished Harmony

Leibniz maintained that created substances were real causes, that God was not the only causally efficacious being (that is, that occasionalism was false), and that intersubstantial causation could not be understood in terms of a physical influx. So, what was Leibniz’s account of causation?

Leibniz’s account of causation was in terms of his famous doctrine of the preestablished harmony. This doctrine contains three main ingredients:

(1) No state of a created substance has as a real cause some state of another created substance (that is, a denial of intersubstantial causality).

(2) Every non-initial, non-miraculous, state of a created substance has as a real cause some previous state of that very substance (that is, an affirmation of intrasubstantial causality).

(3) Each created substance is programmed at creation such that all its natural states and actions are carried out in conformity with––in preestablished harmony with––all the natural states and actions of every other created substance.

Consider the above claims in application to the mind-body relation. Leibniz held that for any mental state, the real cause of that state is neither a state of a body nor the state of some other mind. And for any bodily state, the real cause of that state is neither a state of a mind nor the state of some other body. Further, every non-initial, non-miraculous, mental state of a substance has as a real cause some previous state of that very mind, and every non-initial, non-miraculous, bodily state has as a real cause some previous state of that very body. Finally, created minds and bodies are programmed at creation such that all their natural states and actions are carried out in mutual coordination, with no intersubstantial mind-body causation involved.

For example, suppose that Troy is hit in the head with a hammer (call this bodily state Sb) and pain ensues (call this mental state Sm), a case of apparent body to mind causation. Leibniz would say that in such a case some state of Troy’s mind (soul) prior to Sm was the real cause of Sm, and Sb was not a real causal factor in the obtaining of Sm. Suppose now that Troy has a desire to raise his arm (call this mental state Sm), and the raising of his arm ensues (call this bodily state Sb), a case of apparent mind to body causation. Leibniz would say that in such a case some state of Troy’s body prior to Sb was the real cause of Sb and Sm was not a causal factor in the obtaining of Sb. So although substances do not causally interact, their states accommodate one another as if there were causal interaction among substances.

Mind-body causation was merely one case of causation, for Leibniz believed that a similar analysis is to be given in any case of natural causation. When one billiard ball in motion causes another one to move, there exists, metaphysically speaking, no real interaction between them. Rather, the struck billiard ball moved spontaneously upon contact by the billiard ball in motion. It did so in perfect harmony, that is, in such a way that it appears as though the first causes the second to move. All of this is summarized in Leibniz’s New System of Nature (1695), right after his rejection of occasionalism and physical influx:

Therefore, since I was forced to agree that it is not possible for the soul or any other true substance to receive something from without … I was led, little by little, to a view that surprised me, but which seems inevitable, and which, in fact, has very great advantages and rather considerable beauty. That is, we must say that God originally created the soul (and any other real unity) in such a way that everything must arise for it from its own depths, through a perfect spontaneity relative to itself, and yet with a perfect conformity relative to external things. … There will be a perfect agreement among all these substances, producing the same effect that would be noticed if they communicated through the transmission of species or qualities, as the common philosophers imagine they do. (GP IV, 484 [AG 143f.])

In the last sentence of the above passage, Leibniz refers to what the “common philosophers imagine.” As we have seen, Leibniz is here referring to those who endorse influx theory, the view that postulates “the transmission of species or qualities” (see Against Influx Theory above). Although Leibniz clearly found this theory unacceptable at the end of the day, he did nonetheless indicate that it is an acceptable way of understanding phenomenal nature. It is worth underscoring this point as it helps to highlight what exactly Leibniz has in mind. He writes in the New System:

Besides all the advantages that recommend this hypothesis [that is, preestablished harmony], we can say that it is something more than a hypothesis, since it hardly seems possible to explain things in any other intelligible way, … Our ordinary ways of speaking may also be easily preserved. For we may say that the substance whose state explains a change in an intelligible way (so that we may conclude that it is this substance to which the others have in this respect been adapted from the beginning, in accordance with the order of the decrees of God) is the one which, so far as this change goes, we should therefore think of as acting upon the others. Furthermore, the action of one substance on another is neither the emission nor the transplanting of an entity, as commonly conceived, and it can be reasonably understood only in the way I have just described. It is true that we can easily understand in connection with matter both the emission and receiving of parts, by means of which we quite properly explain all the phenomena of physics mechanically. But a material mass is not a substance, and so it is clear that action as regards an actual substance can only be as I have described. (GP IV, 487 [WF 20]; my emphasis)

There are at least two points worth emphasizing in this passage. First, Leibniz was clearly aware that his theory was at odds with common sense, that is, it is at odds with “our ordinary ways of speaking.” As the above passage indicates, he was concerned to preserve our usual ways of speaking about causal interactions. As a result, Leibniz held that there was a sense in which one could say, for example, that mental events influence bodily events, and vice-versa. He wrote to Antoine Arnauld that although “one particular substance has no physical influence on another … nevertheless, one is quite right to say that my will is the cause of this movement of my arm …; for the one expresses distinctly what the other expresses more confusedly, and one must ascribe the action to the substance whose expression is more distinct” (GP II, 71 [LA 87]). In this passage, Leibniz sets forth what he believed the metaphysical reality of apparent intersubstantial causation amounts to. We begin with the thesis that every created substance perceives the entire universe, though only a portion of it is perceived distinctly, most of it being perceived unconsciously, and, hence, confusedly. Now consider two created substances, x and y (x not identical to y), where some state of x is said to be the cause of some state of y. Leibniz’s analysis is this: when the causal state of affairs occurred, the relevant perceptions of substance x became more distinct, while the relevant perceptions of substance y became more confused. Insofar as the relevant perceptions of x become increasingly distinct, it is “causally” active; insofar as the relevant perceptions of substance y become increasingly confused, it is passive. In general, causation is to be understood as an increase in distinctness on the part of the causally active substance, and an increase in confusedness on the part of the passively effected substance. Again, each substance is programmed at creation to be active/passive at the relevant moment, with no occurrence of real substantial interaction. Thus, ordinary ways of speaking are preserved on the grounds that it is true according to the “distinct/confused analysis” to say that one object is the cause of another.

Second, the above passage indicates that when it comes to a mechanical study of phenomenal nature––that is, when it comes to natural philosophy––the influx model may be used. In a way this is not surprising, for as Leibniz makes clear in this passage, the objects of mechanics are physical masses, and these objects have parts (they have “windows”) via which parts can enter and exit and cause change. They are not substances, which again, have no such parts. So, it appears to be Leibniz’s view that at the level of the most real, the level of substances (monads), preestablished harmony is the correct view. However, the influx model is acceptable at the phenomenal level of mechanics, perhaps as an abstraction from, or idealization of the underlying reality. But note that this level is indeed phenomenal, that is, only an appearance, and any analysis on this level is not the end of the story. Still, for Leibniz, the fact that it is acceptable when it comes to mechanics preserves our ordinary ways of speaking, since it is a model of genuine intersubstantial causation. But such a way of speaking, for Leibniz, is certainly not metaphysically rigorous.

3. Efficient and Final Causation

This last point about different Leibnizian metaphysical levels relates to another unique characteristic of Leibniz’s system. Although at the deepest level of analysis, preestablished harmony reigns supreme in Leibniz’s metaphysics, it is also true that Leibniz embraced a specific taxonomy of types of naturally operative causes, one that incorporated both ancient and modern conceptions of causation. Specifically, Leibniz maintained, in accordance with his belief that the phenomenal level can be treated as engaging in intersubstantial causation, that “laws of efficient causes” govern bodies. Consider the following from the Monadology:

The soul follows its own laws and the body likewise follows its own; and they agree by virtue of the preestablished harmony among all substances, because they are all representations of one self-same universe.

Souls act according to the laws of final causes through appetition, ends, and means. Bodies act according to the laws of efficient causes or of motions. And the two realms, that of efficient causes and that of final causes, are harmonious with one another. (GP VI, 620 [AG 223])

In accordance with the mechanical philosophy that prevailed during Leibniz’s lifetime, he held that the motions of bodies are to be understood as engaging in efficient causal relations, or behaving according to “laws of efficient causes.” But Leibniz also believed, as the above passage indicates, that final causation was prevalent in the world, and that it operated in harmony with the realm of efficient causation. Indeed, in the passage above, Leibniz presented his usual bifurcation of the world into two realms: the bodily realm is governed by efficient causation, and the realm of souls (individual substances) is governed by final causation.

A final cause of some activity is that for which that activity occurs; it is a goal, or end, or purpose of some activity. In claiming that souls act according to final causes, Leibniz seems to have in mind that they are essentially goal driven entities. Any given substance (such as a soul), according to Leibniz, is endowed with two powers: perception and appetite. Leibniz characterizes appetition thus: “The action of the internal principle which brings about the change or the passage from one perception to another may be called appetition” (GP VI, 609 [AG 215]). Appetitions are the ultimate principles of change in the Leibnizian universe, as they are responsible for the activity of the ultimately real things, substances. In claiming, therefore, that substances are governed by laws of final causes, Leibniz has in mind that appetitions lead a substance to strive for certain future perceptual states:

[S]ince the nature of a simple substance consists of perception and appetite, it is clear that there is in each soul a series of appetites and perceptions, through which it is lead from the end to the means, from the perception of one object to the perception of another. (C 14 [MP 175])

It is a matter of some controversy whether Leibniz held that appetitive states of a substance are intrasubstantial productive causes of change (that is, efficient causes of change), and there are texts that can be brought to bear on both sides of the issue. (See Carlin, 2004, 2006; Davidson, 1998; Murray, 1995, 1996; Paull, 1992.) In some passages, Leibniz separates the world into what appear to be functionally autonomous causal realms:

Souls act according to the laws of final causes through appetition, ends, and means. Bodies act according to the laws of efficient causes or of motions. And the two realms, that of efficient causes and that of final causes, are harmonious with one another. (GP VI, 620 [AG 223])

But in other texts, Leibniz seems clearly to suggest that final causes are a species of efficient cause, and hence are productive causes of change. Consider the following:

[T]he present state of body is born from the preceding state through the laws of efficient causes; the present state of the soul is born from its preceding state through the laws of final causes. The one is the place of the series of motion, the other of the series of appetites; the one is passed from cause to effect, the other from end to means. And in fact, it may be said that the representation of the end in the soul is the efficient cause of the representation in the same soul of the means. (Dut, II, 2, 134; my emphasis)

Thus, in this text, Leibniz suggests that final causes themselves produce future perceptions by way of efficient causation.

In this connection, it is worth noting that there is a sense in which final causation is operative at the level of phenomenal bodies as well. “There is,” Leibniz writes in the New Essays, “a moral and voluntary element in what is physical, through its relation to God. . . . [B]odies do not choose for themselves, God having chosen for them” (A VI, 6, 179 [NE 179]). Mechanical bodies, understood as phenomenal hunks of matter, do not exhibit intentionality. Thus, they do not frame their own ends in the way that immaterial substances do. Still, there is a sense in which they are subject to final causes, for they act for the ends that God has set for them, and they do so by way of mechanical efficient causation. Thus, there is some suggestion that Leibniz held that both efficient and final causation permeated the universe at multiple ontological levels.

But whether or not Leibniz believed that both types of causes operated at multiple ontological levels, he did nonetheless believe that the harmony of efficient and final causes explained the ordinary conscious activity of substances, including that sort of activity often cited as involving free will:

[T]he laws that connect the thoughts of the soul in the order of final causes and in accordance with the evolution of perceptions must produce pictures that meet and harmonize with the impressions of bodies on our organs; and likewise the laws of movements in the body, which follow one another in the order of efficient causes, meet and so harmonize with the thoughts of the soul that the body is induced to act at the time when the soul wills it. (GP VI, 137 [T 62])

Although it might appear to some that such a view is inconsistent with freedom of the will, Leibniz did not think so, for he repeatedly maintained that human souls, though governed by preestablished laws of final causes, act with freedom of the will (e.g. GP VII, 419 [L 716f.]). (Whether he was entitled to such a view is another matter.) It is also worth noting that in a number of passages, Leibniz argues that this harmony between types of causation accounts for the very union of the human body and soul (cf. GP VI, 599 [AG 208]).

Finally, Leibniz does not restrict his doctrine of final causation to the conscious activity of rational agents, for he seems to recognize final causal activity everywhere in his system. Consider the following from his Notes on Stahl:

[T]hat motion is not improperly called voluntary, which is connected with a known distinct appetite, where we notice the means at the hands of our soul, being adapted to the end itself; although in other [non-voluntary] movement also, appetites proceed to their own ends through means, albeit they are not noticed by us. (Dut II, 2, 136; my emphasis)

Here Leibniz claimed that final causes operate at the level of the unconscious: a mental state can function as a final cause without our being aware of it. In a letter of 8 May 1704 to Sophie Charlotte, Leibniz made essentially the same point: “So that even in our instinctive or involuntary actions, where it seems only the body plays a part, there is in the soul an appetite for good or an aversion to evil which directs it, even though our reflection is not able to pick it out in the confusion” (GP III, 347 [WF 224f.]). It seems to follow that the preestablished harmony between efficient and final causes has wider application than one might suppose at first glance.

4. Divine Conservation and Concurrence

Although Leibniz maintained against the occasionalists and Spinoza that created substances were genuine sources of their own activity, and that it is not true that God alone is the source of all natural activity, he did nonetheless believe in a doctrine of divine conservation and concurrence. Briefly, according to the latter, God is not an absentee creator, but is involved in every aspect of the natural world, including the causal activity of created substances. Since Leibniz held that creatures are real causes of their own actions, this means that both God and creatures concur in bringing about the effects of the actions of created substances.

Although the texts on this aspect of Leibniz’s theory of natural causation are notoriously thorny, the following passage seems to represent what is his considered view:

The concurrence of God consists in giving us continually whatever there is of reality in us and our actions, insofar as it contains some perfection; but what there is therein of limitation or imperfection is a consequence of preceding limitations, which are originally in the creature. (GP VI, 340 [T 377])

In general, the idea seems to be this: creatures are real causes of the imperfections in actions, while God is responsible for the perfection contained in the action. But this general idea seems clearly inconsistent with a number of other doctrines put forth by Leibniz. For example, there is reason to believe that he holds that a substance can be said to act only insofar as it tends towards perfection (cf. GP VI, 615 [AG 219]). If this is the case, then in conjunction with the passage above, it appears that God is the only active agent. Moreover, Leibniz, along with many other seventeenth century thinkers, held that divine conservation of the world amounts to a continual recreation of every substance and all their states. If this is the case, one is left wondering how not to slip into the occasionalism of Malebranche, for it would seem once again that creatures are not producing anything. This notoriously difficult topic has recently spawned a body of secondary literature, as commentators have struggled with the apparent inconsistencies. (Adams, 1994; Lee, 2004; Sleigh, 1990)

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

References to works of Leibniz are cited by abbreviation according to the key below. Each one is cited by page number unless otherwise noted. ASämtliche Schriften und Briefe. Multiple volumes in seven series. Edited by the German Academy of Sciences. Darmstadt and Berlin: Berlin Academy, 1923–. Cited by series, volume, and page.

AG
Philosophical Essays.
Edited and translated by Roger Ariew and Daniel Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.
Dut
Opera Omnia.
Edited by L. Dutens. Geneva: Fratres De Tournes, 1768. Cited by volume, and page.
GP
Die Philosophischen Schriften von Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz.
7 vols. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin: Weidman, 1875-1890. Cited by volume and page.
L
Philosophical Papers and Letters.
Edited by Leroy Loemker, 2nd ed. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1969.
LA
The Leibniz-Arnauld Correspondence.
Translated and edited by H.T. Mason. Manchester: Manchester UP, 1967.
MP
Philosophical Writings.
Translated and edited by Mary Morris and G.H.R. Parkinson. London: Dent, 1973.
NE
New Essays on Human Understanding.
Translated and edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathon Bennett. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1982. The original French text is in A VI, 6.
T
Theodicy.
Edited by Austin Farrer and translated by E.M. Huggard. New Haven: Yale UP, 1952. Cited by section number as in GP VI.
WF
Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts.
Translated and edited by R.S. Woolhouse and Richard Francks. Oxford: Oxford UP, 1997.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Adams, Robert. 1994. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. Oxford: Oxford UP.
    • A classic and thorough discussion of Leibniz’s views on a number of topics, including human and divine causation. The book consults a wealth of primary sources.
  • Gregory Brown, 1992. “Is There a Pre-Established Harmony of Aggregates in the Leibnizian Dynamics, or Do Non-Substantial Bodies Interact?,” Journal of the History of Philosophy 30, pp. 53-75.
    • This article argues that Leibnizian aggregates do not interact in Leibniz’s physics, and also discusses the importance of distinguishing ontological levels in Leibniz’s philosophy.
  • Carlin, Laurence. 2006. “Leibniz on Final Causes,” Journal of the History of Philosophy 44 (2), pp. 217-233.
    • This paper argues that for Leibniz, final causes are species of efficient cause, and are therefore just as productive as efficient causes.
  • Carlin, Laurence. 2004. “Leibniz on Conatus, Causation, and Freedom,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 85 (4), pp. 365–379.
    • This paper argues that Leibniz was a causal determinist by focusing on his treatment of causation in relation to his concept of conatus, or his concept of force in his physics.
  • Cover, Jan and Mark Kulstad, eds. 1990. Central Themes in Early Modern Philosophy. Indianapolis:Hackett.
    • This is an anthology that contains a number of articles of causation in early modern philosophy, including an article on the relationship between Leibniz and occasionalism.
  • Davidson, Jack. 1998. “Imitators of God: Leibniz on Human Freedom,” Journal of the History of Philosophy 36, pp. 387–421.
    • This paper argues that Leibniz was a causal determinist on the grounds that his model of human volition imitates the model of divine agency.
  • Garber, Daniel. 1994. “Leibniz: Physics and Philosophy” in Jolley, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Philosophy, pp. 270-352.
    • This article is a sustained treatment on Leibniz’s views of the interaction between dynamical bodies, the laws of nature, and efficient and final causation.
  • Jolley, Nicholas. 1994. The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz. Cambridge: Cambridge UP.
    • This anthology contains articles on many aspects of Leibniz’s philosophy. It is written by leading scholars, and could very well be the first place to look for someone new to Leibniz.
  • Kulstad, Mark. 1990. “Appetition in the Philosophy of Leibniz.” In A. Heinkemp, W. Lenzen, and M. Schneider, eds., Mathesis Rationis, pp. 133-151.
    • This is a through examination of Leibniz’s concept of appetition, and is particularly helpful in relating appetition to his physics and to human volition.
  • Lee, Sukjae. 2004. “Leibniz on Divine Concurrence.” Philosophical Review 113 (2), pp. 203-248.
    • This paper is a close and controversial examination on Leibniz’s doctrines of divine conservation and concurrence.
  • Murray, Michael. 1995. “Leibniz on Divine Foreknowledge of Future Contingents and Human Freedom.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 55: 75-108.
    • This article argues that Leibniz was not a causal determinist, contrary to what others have argued.
  • Murray, Michael.. 1996. “Intellect, Will, and Freedom: Leibniz and His Precursors.” The Leibniz Society Review 6: 25-60.
    • This paper develops the interpretation in Murray (1995) by drawing on a wealth of historical sources, including medieval philosophers’ treatment of the concept of moral necessity.
  • Nadler, Steven, ed. 1993. Causation in Early Modern Philosophy. University Park: Penn State UP.
    • This collection of papers is the classic source for papers on causation in early modern philosophy.
  • O’Neill, Eileen. (1993) “Influxus Physicus.” In Nadler, Steven, ed. Causation in Early Modern Philosophy, pp. 27-57.
    • This paper traces the history of the physical influx theory, and analyses its main tenets. It has become the classic treatment of the issue.
  • Paull, R. Cranston. 1992. “Leibniz and the Miracle of Freedom,” Nous 26: 218-235.
    • This paper contains an argument for the conclusion that Leibniz was not a causal determinist. It draws attention to certain passages that appear troubling for the causal determinist reading.
  • Rutherford, Donald. 1995. Leibniz and the Rational Order of Nature. Cambridge: Cambridge UP.
    • This book contains excellent discussions of Leibniz’s views on the properties of the best possible world, and is particularly helpful on the topic of how the level of efficient causes relates to the level of final causes.
  • Rutherford, Donald. 1993. “Natures, Laws, and Miracles: The Roots of Leibniz’s Critique of Occasionalism” in Nadler, Steven, ed. Causation in Early Modern Philosophy, pp. 135-158.
    • A clear discussion of exactly why Leibniz disagrees with Malebranche’s occasionalism. The article challenges some scholars’ interpretations.
  • Sleigh, Robert C. 1990. Leibniz and Arnauld: A Commentary on Their Correspondence. New Haven: Yale UP.
    • This book examines a number of Leibniz’s views on contingent, substance, and causation in the context of Leibniz’s classic exchange with Antoine Arnauld. It also contains helpful discussions of Leibniz’s treatment of occasionalism.
  • Sleigh, Robert C.1990. “Leibniz on Malebranche on Causality” in Cover and Kulstad, eds. Central Themes in Early Modern Philosophy, pp. 161-194.
    • This is a helpful discussion of Leibniz’s reaction to Malebranche’s occasionalism.
  • Wilson, Margaret. 1976. “Leibniz’s Dynamics and Contingency in Nature” in Machamer and Turnbull, eds., Motion and Time, Space and Matter, pp. 264-289.
    • This is a discussion of Leibniz’s belief that the causal laws of nature must be grounded in considerations about final causes.

Author Information

Laurence Carlin
Email: carlin@uwosh.edu
University of Wisconsin, Oshkosh
U. S. A.

Libertarianism

libertyWhat it means to be a “libertarian” in a political sense is a contentious issue, especially among libertarians themselves. There is no single theory that can be safely identified as the libertarian theory, and probably no single principle or set of principles on which all libertarians can agree. Nevertheless, there is a certain family resemblance among libertarian theories that can serve as a framework for analysis. Although there is much disagreement about the details, libertarians are generally united by a rough agreement on a cluster of normative principles, empirical generalizations, and policy recommendations. Libertarians are committed to the belief that individuals, and not states or groups of any other kind, are both ontologically and normatively primary; that individuals have rights against certain kinds of forcible interference on the part of others; that liberty, understood as non-interference, is the only thing that can be legitimately demanded of others as a matter of legal or political right; that robust property rights and the economic liberty that follows from their consistent recognition are of central importance in respecting individual liberty; that social order is not at odds with but develops out of individual liberty; that the only proper use of coercion is defensive or to rectify an error; that governments are bound by essentially the same moral principles as individuals; and that most existing and historical governments have acted improperly insofar as they have utilized coercion for plunder, aggression, redistribution, and other purposes beyond the protection of individual liberty.

In terms of political recommendations, libertarians believe that most, if not all, of the activities currently undertaken by states should be either abandoned or transferred into private hands. The most well-known version of this conclusion finds expression in the so-called “minimal state” theories of Robert Nozick, Ayn Rand, and others (Nozick 1974; Rand 1963a, 1963b) which hold that states may legitimately provide police, courts, and a military, but nothing more. Any further activity on the part of the state—regulating or prohibiting the sale or use of drugs, conscripting individuals for military service, providing taxpayer-funded support to the poor, or even building public roads—is itself rights-violating and hence illegitimate.

Libertarian advocates of a strictly minimal state are to be distinguished from two closely related groups, who favor a smaller or greater role for government, and who may or may not also label themselves “libertarian.” On one hand are so-called anarcho-capitalists who believe that even the minimal state is too large, and that a proper respect for individual rights requires the abolition of government altogether and the provision of protective services by private markets. On the other hand are those who generally identify themselves as classical liberals. Members of this group tend to share libertarians’ confidence in free markets and skepticism over government power, but are more willing to allow greater room for coercive activity on the part of the state so as to allow, say, state provision of public goods or even limited tax-funded welfare transfers.

Table of Contents

  1. The Diversity of Libertarian Theories
  2. Natural Rights Libertarianism
    1. Historical Roots: Locke
    2. Contemporary Natural Rights: Nozick
    3. Criticisms of Natural Rights Libertarianism
      1. Principle of Self-Ownership
      2. Derivation of Full Private Property Ownership from Self-Ownership
  3. Consequentialist Libertarianism
    1. Quantitative Utilitarianism
      1. The Tragedy of the Commons and Private Property
      2. The Invisible Hand and Free Exchange
      3. Arguments Against Government Intervention
    2. Traditionalist Consequentialism
    3. Criticisms of Consequentialist Libertarianism
  4. Anarcho-Capitalism
  5. Other Approaches to Libertarianism
    1. Teleological Libertarianism
    2. Contractarian Libertarianism
    3. Conclusion: Libertarianism as an Overlapping Consensus
  6. References and Further Reading

1. The Diversity of Libertarian Theories

As this article will use the term, libertarianism is a theory about the proper role of government that can be, and has been, supported on a number of different metaphysical, epistemological, and moral grounds. Some libertarians are theists who believe that the doctrine follows from a God-made natural law. Others are atheists who believe it can be supported on purely secular grounds. Some libertarians are rationalists who deduce libertarian conclusions from axiomatic first principles. Others derive their libertarianism from empirical generalizations or a reliance on evolved tradition. And when it comes to comprehensive moral theories, libertarians represent an almost exhaustive array of positions. Some are egoists who believe that individuals have no natural duties to aid their fellow human beings, while others adhere to moral doctrines that hold that the better-off have significant duties to improve the lot of the worse-off. Some libertarians are deontologists, while others are consequentialists, contractarians, or virtue-theorists. Understanding libertarianism as a narrow, limited thesis about the proper moral standing, and proper zone of activity, of the state—and not a comprehensive ethical or metaphysical doctrine—is crucial to making sense of this otherwise baffling diversity of broader philosophic positions.

This article will focus primarily on libertarianism as a philosophic doctrine. This means that, rather than giving close scrutiny to the important empirical claims made both in support and criticism of libertarianism, it will focus instead on the metaphysical, epistemological, and especially moral claims made by the discussants. Those interested in discussions of the non-philosophical aspects of libertarianism can find some recommendations in the reference list below.

Furthermore, this article will focus almost exclusively on libertarian arguments regarding just two philosophical subjects: distributive justice and political authority. There is a danger that this narrow focus will be misleading, since it ignores a number of interesting and important arguments that libertarians have made on subjects ranging from free speech to self-defense, to the proper social treatment of the mentally ill. More generally, it ignores the ways in which libertarianism is a doctrine of social or civil liberty, and not just one of economic liberty. For a variety of reasons, however, the philosophic literature on libertarianism has mostly ignored these other aspects of the theory, and so this article, as a summary of that literature, will generally reflect that trend.

2. Natural Rights Libertarianism

Probably the most well-known and influential version of libertarianism, at least among academic philosophers, is that based upon a theory of natural rights. Natural rights theories vary, but are united by a common belief that individuals have certain moral rights simply by virtue of their status as human beings, that these rights exist prior to and logically independent of the existence of government, and that these rights constrain the ways in which it is morally permissible for both other individuals and governments to treat individuals.

a. Historical Roots: Locke

Although one can find some earlier traces of this doctrine among, for instance, the English Levellers or the Spanish School of Salamanca, John Locke‘s political thought is generally recognized as the most important historical influence on contemporary natural rights versions of libertarianism. The most important elements of Locke’s theory in this respect, set out in his Second Treatise, are his beliefs about the law of nature, and his doctrine of property rights in external goods.

Locke’s idea of the law of nature draws on a distinction between law and government that has been profoundly influential on the development of libertarian thought. According to Locke, even if no government existed over men, the state of nature would nevertheless not be a state of “license.” In other words, men would still be governed by law, albeit one that does not originate from any political source (c.f. Hayek 1973, ch. 4). This law, which Locke calls the “law of nature” holds that “being all equal and independent, no one ought to harm another in his life, liberty, or possessions” (Locke 1952, para. 6). This law of nature serves as a normative standard to govern human conduct, rather than as a description of behavioral regularities in the world (as are other laws of nature like, for instance, the law of gravity). Nevertheless, it is a normative standard that Locke believes is discoverable by human reason, and that binds us all equally as rational agents.

Locke’s belief in a prohibition on harming others stems from his more basic belief that each individual “has a property in his own person” (Locke 1952, para. 27). In other words, individuals are self-owners. Throughout this essay we will refer to this principle, which has been enormously influential on later libertarians, as the “self-ownership principle.” Though controversial, it has generally been taken to mean that each individual possesses over her own body all those rights of exclusive use that we normally associate with property in external goods. But if this were all that individuals owned, their liberties and ability to sustain themselves would obviously be extremely limited. For almost anything we want to do—eating, walking, even breathing, or speaking in order to ask another’s permission—involves the use of external goods such as land, trees, or air. From this, Locke concludes, we must have some way of acquiring property in those external goods, else they will be of no use to anyone. But since we own ourselves, Locke argues, we therefore also own our labor. And by “mixing” our labor with external goods, we can come to own those external goods too. This allows individuals to make private use of the world that God has given to them in common. There is a limit, however, to this ability to appropriate external goods for private use, which Locke captures in his famous “proviso” that holds that a legitimate act of appropriation must leave “enough, and as good… in common for others” (Locke 1952, para. 27). Still, even with this limit, the combination of time, inheritance, and differential abilities, motivation, and luck will lead to possibly substantial inequalities in wealth between persons, and Locke acknowledges this as an acceptable consequence of his doctrine (Locke 1952, para. 50).

b. Contemporary Natural Rights: Nozick

By far the single most important influence on the perception of libertarianism among contemporary academic philosophers was Robert Nozick in his book, Anarchy, State, and Utopia (1974). This book is an explanation and exploration of libertarian rights that attempts to show how a minimal, and no more than a minimal, state can arise via an “invisible hand” process out of a state of nature without violating the rights of individuals; to challenge the highly influential claims of John Rawls that purport to show that a more-than-minimal state was justified and required to achieve distributive justice; and to show that a regime of libertarian rights could establish a “framework for utopia” wherein different individuals would be free to seek out and create mediating institutions to help them achieve their own distinctive visions of the good life.

The details of Nozick’s arguments can be found at Robert Nozick. Here, we will just briefly point out a few elements of particular importance in understanding Nozick’s place in contemporary libertarian thought—his focus on the “negative” aspects of liberty and rights, his Kantian defense of rights, his historical theory of entitlement, and his acceptance of a modified Lockean proviso on property acquisition. A discussion of his argument for the minimal state can be found in the section on anarcho-capitalism below.

First, Nozick, like almost all natural rights libertarians, stresses negative liberties and rights above positive liberties and rights. The distinction between positive and negative liberty, made famous by Isaiah Berlin (Berlin 1990), is often thought of as a distinction between “freedom to” and “freedom from.” One has positive liberty when one has the opportunity and ability to do what one wishes (or, perhaps, what one “rationally” wishes or “ought” to wish). One has negative liberty, on the other hand, when there is an absence of external interferences to one’s doing what one wishes—specifically, when there is an absence of external interferences by other people. A person who is too sick to gather food has his negative liberty intact—no one is stopping him from gathering food—but not his positive liberty as he is unable to gather food even though he wants to do so. Nozick and most libertarians see the proper role of the state as protecting negative liberty, not as promoting positive liberty, and so toward this end Nozick focuses on negative rights as opposed to positive rights. Negative rights are claims against others to refrain from certain kinds of actions against you. Positive rights are claims against others to perform some sort of positive action. Rights against assault, for instance, are negative rights, since they simply require others not to assault you. Welfare rights, on the other hand, are positive rights insofar as they require others to provide you with money or services. By enforcing negative rights, the state protects our negative liberty. It is an empirical question whether enforcing merely negative rights or, as more left-liberal philosophers would promote, enforcing a mix of both negative and positive rights would better promote positive liberty.

Second, while Nozick agrees with the broadly Lockean picture of the content and government-independence of natural law and natural rights, his remarks in defense of those rights draw their inspiration more from Immanuel Kant than from Locke. Nozick does not provide a full-blown argument to justify libertarian rights against other non-libertarian rights theories—a point for which he has been widely criticized, most famously by Thomas Nagel (Nagel 1975). But what he does say in their defense suggests that he sees libertarian rights as an entailment of the other-regarding element in Kant’s second formulation of the categorical imperative—that we treat the humanity in ourselves and others as an end in itself, and never merely as a means. According to Nozick, both utilitarianism and theories that uphold positive rights sanction the involuntary sacrifice of one individual’s interests for the sake of others. Only libertarian rights, which for Nozick take the form of absolute side-constraints against force and fraud, show proper respect for the separateness of persons by barring such sacrifice altogether, and allowing each individual the liberty to pursue his or her own goals without interference.

Third, it is important to note that Nozick’s libertarianism evaluates the justice of states of affairs, such as distributions of property, in terms of the history or process by which that state of affairs arose, and not by the extent to which it satisfies what he calls a patterned or end-state principle of justice. Distributions of property are just, according to Nozick, if they arose from previously just distributions by just procedures. Discerning the justice of current distributions thus requires that we establish a theory of justice in transfer—to tell us which procedures constitute legitimate means of transferring ownership between persons—and a theory of justice in acquisition—to tell us how individuals might come to own external goods that were previously owned by no one. And while Nozick does not fully develop either of these theories, his skeletal position is nevertheless significant, for it implies that it is only the proper historical pedigree that makes a distribution just, and it is only deviations from the proper pedigree that renders a distribution unjust. An implication of this position is that one cannot discern from time-slice statistical data alone—such as the claim that the top fifth of the income distribution in the United States controls more than 80 percent of the nation’s wealth—that a distribution is unjust. Rather, the justice of a distribution depends on how it came about—by force or by trade? By differing degrees of hard work and luck? Or by fraud and theft? Libertarianism’s historical focus thus sets the doctrine against both outcome-egalitarian views that hold that only equal distributions are just, utilitarian views that hold that distributions are just to the extent they maximize utility, and prioritarian views that hold that distributions are just to the extent they benefit the worse-off. Justice in distribution is a matter of respecting people’s rights, not of achieving a certain outcome.

The final distinctive element of Nozick’s view is his acceptance of a modified version of the Lockean proviso as part of his theory of justice in acquisition. Nozick reads Locke’s claim that legitimate acts of appropriation must leave enough and as good for others as a claim that such appropriations must not worsen the situation of others (Nozick 1974, 175, 178). On the face of it, this seems like a small change from Locke’s original statement, but Nozick believes it allows for much greater freedom for free exchange and capitalism (Nozick 1974, 182). Nozick reaches this conclusion on the basis of certain empirical beliefs about the beneficial effects of private property:

it increases the social product by putting means of production in the hands of those who can use them most efficiently (profitably); experimentation is encouraged, because with separate persons controlling resources, there is no one person or small group whom someone with a new idea must convince to try it out; private property enables people to decide on the pattern and type of risks they wish to bear, leading to specialized types of risk bearing; private property protects future persons by leading some to hold back resources from current consumption for future markets; it provides alternative sources of employment for unpopular persons who don’t have to convince any one person or small group to hire them, and so on. (Nozick 1974, 177)

If these assumptions are correct, then persons might not be made worse off by acts of original appropriation even if those acts fail to leave enough and as good for others to appropriate. Private property and the capitalist markets to which it gives rise generate an abundance of wealth, and latecomers to the appropriation game (like people today) are in a much better position as a result. As David Schmidtz puts the point:

Original appropriation diminishes the stock of what can be originally appropriated, at least in the case of land, but that is not the same thing as diminishing the stock of what can be owned. On the contrary, in taking control of resources and thereby removing those particular resources from the stock of goods that can be acquired by original appropriation, people typically generate massive increases in the stock of goods that can be acquired by trade. The lesson is that appropriation is typically not a zero-sum game. It normally is a positive-sum game. (Schmidtz and Goodin 1998, 30)

Relative to their level of well-being in a world where nothing is privately held, then, individuals are generally not made worse off by acts of private appropriation. Thus, Nozick concludes, the Lockean proviso will “not provide a significant opportunity for future state action” in the form of redistribution or regulation of private property (Nozick 1974, 182).

c. Criticisms of Natural Rights Libertarianism

Nozick’s libertarian theory has been subject to criticism on a number of grounds. Here we will focus on two primary categories of criticism of Lockean/Nozickian natural rights libertarianism—namely, with respect to the principle of self-ownership and the derivation of private property rights from self-ownership.

i. Principle of Self-Ownership

Criticisms of the self-ownership principle generally take one of two forms. Some arguments attempt to sever the connection between the principle of self-ownership and the more fundamental moral principles that are thought to justify it. Nozick’s suggestion that self-ownership is warranted by the Kantian principle that no one should be treated as a mere means, for instance, is criticized by G.A. Cohen on the grounds that policies that violate self-ownership by forcing the well-off to support the less advantaged do not necessarily treat the well-off merely as means (Cohen 1995, 239–241). We can satisfy Kant’s imperative against treating others as mere means without thereby committing ourselves to full self-ownership, Cohen argues, and we have good reason to do so insofar as the principle of self-ownership has other, implausible, consequences. The same general pattern of argument holds against more intuitive defenses of the self-ownership principle. Nozick’s concern (Nozick 1977, 206), elaborated by Cohen (Cohen 1995, 70), that theories that deny self-ownership might license the forcible transfer of eyes from the sight-endowed to the blind, for instance, or Murray Rothbard’s claim that the only alternatives to self-ownership are slavery or communism (Rothbard 1973, 29), have been met with the response that a denial of the permissibility of slavery, communism, and eye-transplants can be made—and usually better made—on grounds other than self-ownership.

Other criticisms of self-ownership focus on the counterintuitive or otherwise objectionable implications of self-ownership. Cohen, for instance, argues that recognizing rights to full self-ownership allows individuals’ lives to be objectionably governed by brute luck in the distribution of natural assets, since the self that people own is largely a product of their luck in receiving a good or bad genetic endowment, and being raised in a good or bad environment (Cohen 1995, 229). Richard Arneson, on the other hand, has argued that self-ownership conflicts with Pareto-Optimality (Arneson 1991). His concern is that since self-ownership is construed by libertarians as an absolute right, it follows that it cannot be violated even in small ways and even when great benefit would accrue from doing so. Thus, to modify David Hume, absolute rights of self-ownership seem to prevent us from scratching the finger of another even to prevent the destruction of the whole world. And although the real objection here seems to be to the absoluteness of self-ownership rights, rather than to self-ownership rights as such, it remains unclear whether strict libertarianism can be preserved if rights of self-ownership are given a less than absolute status.

ii. Derivation of Full Private Property Ownership from Self-Ownership

Even if individuals have absolute rights to full self-ownership, it can still be questioned whether there is a legitimate way of moving from ownership of the self to ownership of external goods.

Left-libertarians, such as Hillel Steiner, Peter Vallentyne, and Michael Otsuka, grant the self-ownership principle but deny that it can yield full private property rights in external goods, especially land (Steiner 1994; Vallentyne 2000; Otsuka 2003). Natural resources, such theorists hold, belong to everyone in some equal way, and private appropriation of them amounts to theft. Rather than returning all such goods to the state of nature, however, most left-libertarians suggest that those who claim ownership of such resources be subjected to a tax to compensate others for the loss of their rights of use. Since the tax is on the value of the external resource and not on individuals’ natural talents or efforts, it is thought that this line of argument can provide a justification for a kind of egalitarian redistribution that is compatible with full individual self-ownership.

While left-libertarians doubt that self-ownership can yield full private property rights in external goods, others are doubtful that the concept is determinate enough to yield any theory of justified property ownership at all. Locke’s metaphor on labor mixing, for instance, is intuitively appealing, but notoriously difficult to work out in detail (Waldron 1983). First, it is not clear why mixing one’s labor with something generates any rights at all. As Nozick himself asks, “why isn’t mixing what I own with what I don’t own a way of losing what I own rather than a way of gaining what I don’t?” (Nozick 1974, 174–175). Second, it is not clear what the scope of the rights generated by labor-mixing are. Again, Nozick playfully suggests (but does not answer) this question when he asks whether a person who builds a fence around virgin land thereby comes to own the enclosed land, or simply the fence, or just the land immediately under it. But the point is more worrisome than Nozick acknowledges. For as critics such as Barbara Fried have pointed out, following Hohfeld, property ownership is not a single right but a bundle of rights, and it is far from clear which “sticks” from this bundle individuals should come to control by virtue of their self-ownership (Fried 2004). Does one’s ownership right over a plot of land entail the right to store radioactive waste on it? To dam the river that runs through it? To shine a very bright light from it in the middle of the night (Friedman 1989, 168)? Problems such as these must, of course, be resolved by any political theory—not just libertarians. The problem is that the concept of self-ownership seems to offer little, if any, help in doing so.

3. Consequentialist Libertarianism

While Nozickian libertarianism finds its inspiration in Locke and Kant, there is another species of libertarianism that draws its influence from David Hume, Adam Smith, and John Stuart Mill. This variety of libertarianism holds its political principles to be grounded not in self-ownership or the natural rights of humanity, but in the beneficial consequences that libertarian rights and institutions produce, relative to possible and realistic alternatives. To the extent that such theorists hold that consequences, and only consequences, are relevant in the justification of libertarianism, they can properly be labeled a form of consequentialism. Some of these consequentialist forms of libertarianism are utilitarian. But consequentialism is not identical to utilitarianism, and this section will explore both traditional quantitative utilitarian defenses of libertarianism, and other forms more difficult to classify.

a. Quantitative Utilitarianism

Philosophically, the approach that seeks to justify political institutions by demonstrating their tendency to maximize utility has its clearest origins in the thought of Jeremy Bentham, himself a legal reformer as well as moral theorist. But, while Bentham was no advocate of unfettered laissez-faire, his approach has been enormously influential among economists, especially the Austrian and Chicago Schools of Economics, many of whom have utilized utilitarian analysis in support of libertarian political conclusions. Some influential economists have been self-consciously libertarian—the most notable of which being Ludwig von Mises, Friedrich Hayek, James Buchanan, and Milton Friedman (the latter three are Nobel laureates). Richard Epstein, more legal theorist than economist, nevertheless utilizes utilitarian argument with an economic analysis of law to defend his version of classical liberalism. His work in Principles for a Free Society (1998) and Skepticism and Freedom (2003) is probably the most philosophical of contemporary utilitarian defenses of libertarianism. Buchanan’s work is generally described as contractarian, though it certainly draws heavily on utilitarian analysis. It too is highly philosophical.

Utilitarian defenses of libertarianism generally consist of two prongs: utilitarian arguments in support of private property and free exchange and utilitarian arguments against government policies that exceed the bounds of the minimal state. Utilitarian defenses of private property and free exchange are too diverse to thoroughly canvass in a single article. For the purposes of this article, however, the focus will be on two main arguments that have been especially influential: the so-called “Tragedy of the Commons” argument for private property and the “Invisible Hand” argument for free exchange.

i. The Tragedy of the Commons and Private Property

The Tragedy of the Commons argument notes that under certain conditions when property is commonly owned or, equivalently, owned by no one, it will be inefficiently used and quickly depleted. In his original description of the problem of the commons, Garrett Hardin asks us to imagine a pasture open to all, on which various herders graze their cattle (Hardin 1968). Each additional animal that the herder is able to graze means greater profit for the herder, who captures that entire benefit for his or her self. Of course, additional cattle on the pasture has a cost as well in terms of crowding and diminished carrying capacity of the land, but importantly this cost of additional grazing, unlike the benefit, is dispersed among all herders. Since each herder thus receives the full benefit of each additional animal but bears only a fraction of the dispersed cost, it benefits him or her to graze more and more animals on the land. But since this same logic applies equally well to all herders, we can expect them all to act this way, with the result that the carrying capacity of the field will quickly be exceeded.

The tragedy of the Tragedy of the Commons is especially apparent if we model it as a Prisoner’s Dilemma, wherein each party has the option to graze additional animals or not to graze. (See figure 1, below, where A and B represent two herders, “graze” and “don’t graze” their possible options, and the four possible outcomes of their joint action. Within the boxes, the numbers represent the utility each herder receives from the outcome, with A’s outcome listed on the left and B’s on the right). As the discussion above suggests, the best outcome for each individual herder is to graze an additional animal, but for the other herder not to—here the herder reaps all the benefit and only a fraction of the cost. The worst outcome for each individual herder, conversely, is to refrain from grazing an additional animal while the other herder indulges—in this situation, the herder bears costs but receives no benefit. The relationship between the other two possible outcomes is important. Both herders would be better off if neither grazed an additional animal, compared to the outcome in which both do graze an additional animal. The long-term benefits of operating within the carrying capacity of the land, we can assume, outweigh the short-term gains to be had from mutual overgrazing. By the logic of the Prisoner’s Dilemma, however, rational self-interested herders will not choose mutual restraint over mutual exploitation of the resource. This is because, so long as the costs of over-grazing are partially externalized on to other users of the resource, it is in each herder’s interest to overgraze regardless of what the other party does. In the language of game theory, overgrazing dominates restraint. As a result, not only is the resource consumed, but both parties are made worse off individually than they could have been. Mutual overgrazing creates a situation that not only yields a lower total utility than mutual restraint (2 vs. 6), but that is Pareto-inferior to mutual restraint—at least one party (indeed, both!) would have been made better off by mutual restraint without anyone having been made worse off.

B
Don’t Graze
Graze
A
Don’t Graze
3, 3
0, 5
Graze
5, 0
1, 1

Figure 1. The Tragedy of the Commons as Prisoner’s Dilemma

The classic solution to the Tragedy of the Commons is private property. Recall that the tragedy arises because individual herders do not have to bear the full costs of their actions. Because the land is common to all, the costs of overgrazing are partially externalized on to other users of the resource. But private property changes this. If, instead of being commonly owned by all, the field was instead divided into smaller pieces of private property, then herders would have the power to exclude others from using their own property. One would only be able to graze cattle on one’s own field, or on others’ fields on terms specified by their owners, and this means that the costs of that overgrazing (in terms of diminished usability of the land or diminished resale value because of that diminished usability) would be borne by the overgrazer alone. Private property forces individuals to internalize the cost of their actions, and this in turn provides individuals with an incentive to use the resource wisely.

The lesson is that by creating and respecting private property rights in external resources, governments can provide individuals with an incentive to use those resources in an efficient way, without the need for complicated government regulation and oversight of those resources. Libertarians have used this basic insight to argue for everything from privatization of roads (Klein and Fielding 1992) to private property as a solution to various environmental problems (Anderson and Leal 1991).

ii. The Invisible Hand and Free Exchange

Libertarians believe that individuals and groups should be free to trade just about anything they wish with whomever they wish, with little to no governmental restriction. They therefore oppose laws that prohibit certain types of exchanges (such as prohibitions on prostitution and sale of illegal drugs, minimum wage laws that effectively prohibit low-wage labor agreements, and so on) as well as laws that burden exchanges by imposing high transaction costs (such as import tariffs).

The reason utilitarian libertarians support free exchange is that, they argue, it tends to allocate resources into the hands of those who value them most, and in so doing to increase the total amount of utility in society. The first step in seeing this is to understand that even if trade is a zero-sum game in terms of the objects that are traded (nothing is created or destroyed, just moved about), it is a positivesum game in terms of utility. This is because individuals differ in terms of the subjective utility they assign to goods. A person planning to move from Chicago to San Diego might assign a relatively low utility value to her large, heavy furniture. It’s difficult and costly to move, and might not match the style of the new home anyway. But to someone else who has just moved into an empty apartment in Chicago, that furniture might have a very high utility value indeed. If the first person values the furniture at $200 (or its equivalent in terms of utility) and the second person values it at $500, both will gain if they exchange for a price anywhere between those two values. Each will have given up something they value less in exchange for something they value more, and net utility will have increased as a result.

As Friedrich Hayek has noted, much of the information about the relative utility values assigned to different goods is transmitted to different actors in the market via the price system (Hayek 1980). An increase in a resource’s price signals that demand for that resource has increased relative to supply. Consumers can respond to this price increase by continuing to use the resource at the now-higher price, switching to a substitute good, or discontinuing use of that sort of resource altogether. Each individual’s decision is both affected by the price of the relevant resources, and affects the price insofar as it adds to or subtracts from aggregate supply and demand. Thus, though they generally do not know it, each person’s decision is a response to the decisions of millions of other consumers and producers of the resource, each of whom bases her decision on her own specialized, local knowledge about that resource. And although all they are trying to do is maximize their own utility, each individual will be led to act in a way that leads the resource toward its highest-valued use. Those who derive the most utility from the good will outbid others for its use, and others will be led to look for cheaper substitutes.

On this account, one deeply influenced by the Austrian School of Economics, the market is a constantly churning process of competition, discovery, and innovation. Market prices represent aggregates of information and so generally represent an advance over what any one individual could hope to know on his own, but the individual decisions out of which market prices arise are themselves based on imperfect information. There are always opportunities that nobody has discovered, and the passage of time, the changing of people’s preferences, and the development of new technological possibilities ensures that this ignorance will never be fully overcome. The market is thus never in a state of competitive equilibrium, and it will always “fail” by the test of perfect efficiency. But it is precisely today’s market failures that provide the opportunities for tomorrow’s entrepreneurs to profit by new innovation (Kirzner 1996). Competition is a process, not a goal to be reached, and it is a process driven by the particular decisions of individuals who are mostly unaware of the overall and long-term tendencies of their decisions taken as a whole. Even if no market actor cares about increasing the aggregate level of utility in society, he will be, as Adam Smith wrote, “led by an invisible hand to promote an end which was no part of his intention” (Smith 1981). The dispersed knowledge of millions of market actors will be taken into account in producing a distribution that comes as close as practically possible to that which would be selected by a benign, omniscient, and omnipotent despot. In reality, however, all that government is required to do in order to achieve this effect is to define and enforce clear property rights and to allow the price system to freely adjust in response to changing conditions.

iii. Arguments Against Government Intervention

The above two arguments, if successful, demonstrate that free markets and private property generate good utilitarian outcomes. But even if this is true, it remains possible that selective government intervention in the economy could produce outcomes that are even better. Governments might use taxation and coercion for the provision of public goods, or to prevent other sorts of market failures like monopolies. Or governments might engage in redistributive taxation on the grounds that given the diminishing marginal utility of wealth, doing so will provide higher levels of overall utility. In order to maintain their opposition to government intervention, then, libertarians must produce arguments to show that such policies will not produce greater utility than a policy of laissez-faire. Producing such arguments is something of a cottage industry among libertarian economists, and so we cannot hope to provide a complete summary here. Two main categories of argument, however, have been especially influential. We can call them incentive-based arguments and public choice arguments.

Incentive arguments proceed by claiming that government policies designed to promote utility actually produce incentives for individuals to act in ways that run contrary to promotion of utility. Examples of incentive arguments include arguments that (a) government-provided (welfare) benefits dissuade individuals from taking responsibility for their own economic well-being (Murray 1984), (b) mandatory minimum wage laws generate unemployment among low-skilled workers (Friedman 1962, 180–181), (c) legal prohibition of drugs create a black market with inflated prices, low quality control, and violence (Thornton 1991), and (d) higher taxes lead people to work and/or invest less, and hence lead to lower economic growth.

Public choice arguments, on the other hand, are often employed by libertarians to undermine the assumption that government will use its powers to promote the public interest in the way its proponents claim it will. Public choice as a field is based on the assumption that the model of rational self-interest typically employed by economists to predict the behavior of market agents can also be used to predict the behavior of government agents. Rather than trying to maximize profit, however, government agents are thought to be aiming at re-election (in the case of elected officials) or maintenance or expansion of budget and influence (in the case of bureaucrats). From this basic analytical model, public choice theorists have argued that (a) the fact that the costs of many policies are widely dispersed among taxpayers, while their benefits are often concentrated in the hands of a few beneficiaries, means that even grossly inefficient policies will be enacted and, once enacted, very difficult to remove, (b) politicians and bureaucrats will engage in “rent-seeking” behavior by exploiting the powers of their office for personal gain rather than public good, and (c) certain public goods will be over-supplied by political processes, while others will be under-supplied, since government agents lack both knowledge and incentives necessary to provide such goods at efficient levels (Mitchell and Simmons 1994). These problems are held to be endemic to political processes, and not easily subject to legislative or constitutional correction. Hence, many conclude that the only way to minimize the problems of political power is to minimize the scope of political power itself by subjecting as few areas of life as possible to political regulation.

b. Traditionalist Consequentialism

The quantitative utilitarians are often both rationalist and radical in their approach to social reform. For them, the maximization of utility serves as an axiomatic first principle, from which policy conclusions can be straightforwardly deduced once empirical (or quasi-empirical) assessments of causal relationships in the world have been made. From Jeremy Bentham to Peter Singer, quantitative utilitarians have advocated dramatic changes in social institutions, all justified in the name of reason and the morality it gives rise to.

There is, however, another strain of consequentialism that is less confident in the ability of human reason to radically reform social institutions for the better. For these consequentialists, social institutions are the product of an evolutionary process that itself is the product of the decisions of millions of discrete individuals. Each of these individuals in turn possess knowledge that, though by itself is insignificant, in the aggregate represents more than any single social reformer could ever hope to match. Humility, not radicalism, is counseled by this variety of consequentialism.

Though it has its affinities with conservative doctrines such as those of Edmund Burke, Michael Oakeshott, and Russell Kirk, this strain of consequentialism had its greatest influence on libertarianism through the work of Friedrich Hayek. Hayek, however, takes pains to distance himself from conservative ideology, noting that his respect for tradition is not grounded in a fetish for the status quo or an opposition to change as such, but in deeper, distinctively liberal principles (Hayek 1960). For Hayek, tradition is valuable because, and only to the extent that, it evolves in a peaceful, decentralized way. Social norms that are chosen by free individuals and survive competition from competing norms without being maintained by coercion are, for that reason, worthy of respect even if we are not consciously aware of all the reasons that the institution has survived. Somewhat paradoxically then, Hayek believes that we can rationally support institutions even when we lack substantive justifying reasons for supporting them. The reason this can be rational is that even when we lack substantive justifying reasons, we nevertheless have justifying reasons in a procedural sense—the fact that the institution is the result of an evolutionary procedure of a certain sort gives us reason to believe that there are substantive justifying reasons for it, even if we do not know what they are (Gaus 2006).

For Hayek, the procedures that lend justifying force to institutions are, essentially, ones that leave individuals free to act as they wish so long as they do not act aggressively toward others. For Hayek, however, this principle is not a moral axiom but rather follows from his beliefs regarding the limits and uses of knowledge in society. A crucial piece of Hayek’s arguments regarding the price system, (see above) is his claim that each individual possesses a unique set of knowledge about his or her local circumstances, special interests, desires, abilities, and so forth. The price system, if allowed to function freely without artificial floors or ceilings, will reflect this knowledge and transmit it to other interested individuals, thus allowing society to make effective use of dispersed knowledge. But Hayek’s defense of the price system is only one application of a more general point. The fact that knowledge of all sorts exists in dispersed form among many individuals is a fundamental fact about human existence. And since this knowledge is constantly changing in response to changing circumstances and cannot therefore be collected and acted upon by any central authority, the only way to make use of this knowledge effectively is to allow individuals the freedom to act on it themselves. This means that government must disallow individuals from coercing one another, and also must refrain from coercing them themselves. The social order that such voluntary actions produce is one that, given the complexity of social and economic systems and radical limitations on our ability to acquire knowledge about its particular details (Gaus 2007), cannot be imposed by fiat, but must evolve spontaneously in a bottom-up manner. Hayek, like Mill before him (Mill 1989), thus celebrates the fact that a free society allows individuals to engage in “experiments in living” and therefore, as Nozick argued in the neglected third part of his Anarchy, State, and Utopia, can serve as a “utopia of utopias” where individuals are at liberty to organize their own conception of the good life with others who voluntarily choose to share their vision (Hayek 1960).

Hayek’s ideas about the relationship between knowledge, freedom, and a constitutional order were first developed at length in The Constitution of Liberty, later developed in his series Law, Legislation and Liberty, and given their last, and most accessible (though not necessarily most reliable (Caldwell 2005)) statement in The Fatal Conceit: The Errors of Socialism (1988). Since then, the most extensive integration of these ideas into a libertarian framework is in Randy Barnett’s The Structure of Liberty, wherein Barnett argues that a “polycentric constitutional order” (see below regarding anarcho-capitalism) is best suited to solve not only the Hayekian problem of the use of knowledge in society, but also what he calls the problems of “interest” and “power” (Barnett 1998). More recently, Hayekian insights have been put to use by contemporary philosophers Chandran Kukathas (1989; 2006) and Gerald Gaus (2006; 2007).

c. Criticisms of Consequentialist Libertarianism

Consequentialist defenses of libertarianism are, of course, varieties of consequentialist moral argument, and are susceptible therefore to the same kinds of criticisms leveled against consequentialist moral arguments in general. Beyond these standard criticisms, moreover, consequentialist defenses of libertarianism are subject to four special difficulties.

First, consequentialist arguments seem unlikely to lead one to full-fledged libertarianism, as opposed to more moderate forms of classical liberalism. Intuitively, it seems implausible that simple protection of individual negative liberties would do a better job than any alternative institutional arrangement at maximizing utility or peace and prosperity or whatever. And this intuitive doubt is buttressed by economic analyses showing that unregulated capitalist markets suffer from production of negative externalities, from monopoly power, and from undersupply of certain public goods, all of which cry out for some form of government protection (Buchanan 1985). Even granting libertarian claims that (a) these problems are vastly overstated, (b) often caused by previous failures of government to adequately respect or enforce private property rights, and (c) government ability to correct these is not as great as one might think, it’s nevertheless implausible to suppose, a priori, that it will never be the case that government can do a better job than the market by interfering with strict libertarian rights.

Second, consequentialist defenses of libertarianism are subject to objections when a great deal of benefit can be had at a very low cost. So-called cases of “easy rescue,” for instance, challenge the wisdom of adhering to absolute prohibitions on coercive conduct. After all, if the majority of the world’s population lives in dire poverty and suffer from easily preventable diseases and deaths, couldn’t utility be increased by increasing taxes slightly on wealthy Americans and using that surplus to provide basic medical aid to those in desperate need? The prevalence of such cases is an empirical question, but their possibility points (at least) to a “fragility” in the consequentialist case for libertarian prohibitions on redistributive taxation.

Third, the consequentialist theories at the root of these libertarian arguments are often seriously under-theorized. For instance, Randy Barnett bases his defense of libertarian natural rights on the claim that they promote the end of “happiness, peace and prosperity” (Barnett 1998). But this leaves a host of difficult questions unaddressed. The meaning of each of these terms, for instance, has been subject to intense philosophical debate. Which sense of happiness, then, does libertarianism promote? What happens when these ends conflict—when we have to choose, say, between peace and prosperity? And in what sense do libertarian rights “promote” these ends? Are they supposed to maximize happiness in the aggregate? Or to maximize each person’s happiness? Or to maximize the weighted sum of happiness, peace, and prosperity? Richard Epstein is on more familiar and hence, perhaps, firmer ground when he says that his version of classical liberalism is meant to maximize utility, but even here the claim that utility maximization is the proper end of political action is asserted without argument. The lesson is that while consequentialist political arguments might seem less abstract and philosophical (in the pejorative sense) than deontological arguments, consequentialism is still, nevertheless, a moral theory, and needs to be clearly articulated and defended as any other moral theory. Possibly because consequentialist defenses of libertarianism have been put forward mainly by non-philosophers, this challenge has yet to be met.

A fourth and related point has to do with issues surrounding the distribution of wealth, happiness, opportunities, and other goods allegedly promoted by libertarian rights. In part, this is a worry common to all maximizing versions of consequentialism, but it is of special relevance in this context given the close relation between economic systems and distributional issues. The worry is that morality, or justice, requires more than simply producing an abundance of wealth, happiness, or whatever. It requires that each person gets a fair share—whether that is defined as an equal share, a share sufficient for living a good life, or something else. Intuitively fair distributions are simply not something that libertarian institutions can guarantee, devoid as they are of any means for redistributing these goods from the well-off to the less well-off. Furthermore, once it is granted that libertarianism is likely to produce unequal distributions of wealth, the Hayekian argument for relying on the free price system to allocate goods no longer holds as strongly as it appeared to. For we cannot simply assume that a free price system will lead to goods being allocated to their most valued use if some people have an abundance of wealth and others very little at all. A free market of self-interested persons will not distribute bread to the starving man, no matter how much utility he would derive from it, if he cannot pay for it. And a wealthy person, such as Bill Gates, will still always be able to outbid a poor person for season tickets to the Mariners, even if the poor person values the tickets much more highly than he, since the marginal value of the dollars he spends on the tickets is much lower to him than the marginal value of the poor person’s dollars. Both by an external standard of fairness and by an internal standard of utility-maximization, then, unregulated free markets seem to fall short.

4. Anarcho-Capitalism

Anarcho-capitalists claim that no state is morally justified (hence their anarchism), and that the traditional functions of the state ought to be provided by voluntary production and trade instead (hence their capitalism). This position poses a serious challenge to both moderate classical liberals and more radical minimal state libertarians, though, as we shall see, the stability of the latter position is especially threatened by the anarchist challenge.

Anarcho-capitalism can be defended on either consequentialist or deontological grounds, though usually a mix of both arguments is proffered. On the consequentialist side, it is argued that police protection, court systems, and even law itself can be provided voluntarily for a price like any other market good (Friedman 1989; Rothbard 1978; Barnett 1998; Hasnas 2003; Hasnas 2007). And not only is it possible for markets to provide these traditionally state-supplied goods, it is actually more desirable for them to do so given that competitive pressures in this market, as in others, will produce an array of goods that is of higher general quality and that is diverse enough to satisfy individuals’ differing preferences (Friedman 1989; Barnett 1998). Deontologically, anarcho-capitalists argue that the minimal state necessarily violates individual rights insofar as it (1) claims a monopoly on the legitimate use of force and thereby prohibits other individuals from exercising force in accordance with their natural rights, and (2) funds its protective services with coercively obtained tax revenue that it sometimes (3) uses redistributively to pay for protection for those who are unable to pay for themselves (Rothbard 1978; Childs 1994).

Robert Nozick was one of the first academic philosophers to take the anarchist challenge seriously. In the first part of his Anarchy, State, and Utopia he argued that the minimal state can evolve out of an anarcho-capitalist society through an invisible hand process that does not violate anyone’s rights. Competitive pressures and violent conflict, he argued, will provide incentives for competing defensive agencies to merge or collude so that, effectively, monopolies will emerge over certain geographical areas (Nozick 1974). Since these monopolies are merely de facto, however, the dominant protection agency does not yet constitute a state. For that to occur, the “dominant protection agency” must claim that it would be morally illegitimate for other protection agencies to operate, and make some reasonably effective attempt to prohibit them from doing so. Nozick’s argument that it would be legitimate for the dominant protection agency to do so is one of the most controversial aspects of his argument. Essentially, he argues that individuals have rights not to be subject to the risk of rights-violation, and that the dominant protection agency may legitimately prohibit the protective activities of its competitors on grounds that their procedures involve the imposition of risk. In claiming and enforcing this monopoly, the dominant protection agency becomes what Nozick calls the “ultraminimal state”—ultraminimal because it does not provide protective services for all persons within its geographical territory, but only those who pay for them. The transition from the ultraminimal state to the minimal one occurs when the dominant protection agency (now state) provides protective services to all individuals within its territory, and Nozick argues that the state is morally obligated to do this in order to provide compensation to the individuals who have been disadvantaged by its seizure of monopoly power.

Nozick’s arguments against the anarchist have been challenged on a number of grounds. First, the justification for the state it provides is entirely hypothetical—the most he attempts to claim is that a state could arise legitimately from the state of nature, not that any actual state has (Rothbard 1977). But if hypotheticals were all that mattered, then an equally compelling story could be told of how the minimal state could devolve back into merely one competitive agency among others by a process that violates no one’s rights (Childs 1977), thus leaving us at a justificatory stalemate. Second, it is questionable whether prohibiting activities that run the risk of violating rights, but do not actually violate any, is compatible with fundamental liberal principles (Rothbard 1977). Finally, even if the general principle of prohibition with compensation is legitimate, it is nevertheless doubtful that the proper way to compensate the anarchist who has been harmed by the state’s claim of monopoly is to provide him with precisely what he does not want—state police and military services (Childs 1977).

Until decisively rebutted, then, the anarchist position remains a serious challenge for libertarians, especially of the minimal state variety. This is true regardless of whether their libertarianism is defended on consequentialist or natural rights grounds. For the consequentialist libertarian, the challenge is to explain why law and protective services are the only goods that require state provision in order to maximize utility (or whatever the maximandum may be). If, for instance, the consequentialist justification for the state provision of law is that law is a public good, then the question is: Why should other public goods not also be provided? The claim that only police, courts, and military fit the bill appears to be more an a priori article of faith than a consequence of empirical analysis. This consideration might explain why so many consequentialist libertarians are in fact classical liberals who are willing to grant legitimacy to a larger than minimal state (Friedman 1962; Hayek 1960; Epstein 2003). For deontological libertarians, on the other hand, the challenge is to show why the state is justified in (a) prohibiting individuals from exercising or purchasing protective activities on their own and (b) financing protective services through coercive and redistributive taxation. If this sort of prohibition, and this sort of coercion and redistribution is justified, why not others? Once the bright line of non-aggression has been crossed, it is difficult to find a compelling substitute.

This is not to say that anarcho-capitalists do not face challenges of their own. First, many have pointed out that there is a paucity of empirical evidence to support the claim that anarcho-capitalism could function in a modern post-industrial society. Pointing to quasi-examples from Medieval Iceland (Friedman 1979) does little to alleviate this concern (Epstein 2003). Second, even if a plausible case could be made for the market provision of law and private defense, the market provision of national defense, which fits the characteristics of a public good almost perfectly, remains a far more difficult challenge (Friedman 1989). Finally, when it comes to rights and anarchy, one philosopher’s modus ponens is another’s modus tollens. If respect for robust rights of self-ownership and property in external goods, as libertarians understand them, entail anarcho-capitalism, why not then reject these rights rather than embrace anarcho-capitalism? Rothbard, Nozick and other natural rights libertarians are notoriously lacking in foundational arguments to support their strong belief in these rights. In the absence of strong countervailing reasons to accept these rights and the libertarian interpretation of them, the fact that they lead to what might seem to be absurd conclusions could be a decisive reason to reject them.

5. Other Approaches to Libertarianism

This entry has focused on the main approaches to libertarianism popular among academic philosophers. But it has not been exhaustive. There are other philosophical defenses of libertarianism that space prevents exploring in detail, but deserve mention nevertheless. These include defenses of libertarianism that proceed from teleological and contractual considerations.

a. Teleological Libertarianism

One increasingly influential approach takes as its normative foundation a virtue-centered ethical theory. Such theories hold that libertarian political institutions are justified in the way they allow individuals to develop as virtuous agents. Ayn Rand was perhaps the earliest modern proponent of such theory, and while her writings were largely ignored by academics, the core idea has since been picked up and developed with greater sophistication by philosophers like Tara Smith, Douglas Rasmussen, and Douglas Den Uyl (Rasmussen and Den Uyl 1991; 2005).

Teleological versions of libertarianism are in some significant respects similar to consequentialist versions, insofar as they hold that political institutions are to be judged in light of their tendency to yield a certain sort of outcome. But the consequentialism at work here is markedly different from the aggregative and impartial consequentialism of act-utilitarianism. Political institutions are to be judged based on the extent to which they allow individuals to flourish, but flourishing is a value that is agent-relative (and not agent-neutral as is happiness for the utilitarian), and also one that can only be achieved by the self-directed activity of each individual agent (and not something that can be distributed among individuals by the state). It is thus not the job of political institutions to promote flourishing by means of activist policies, but merely to make room for it by enforcing the core set of libertarian rights.

These claims lead to challenges for the teleological libertarian, however. If human flourishing is good, it must be so in an agent-neutral or in an agent-relative sense. If it is good in an agent-neutral sense, then it is unclear why we do not share positive duties to promote the flourishing of others, alongside merely negative duties to refrain from hindering their pursuit of their own flourishing.

Teleological libertarians generally argue that flourishing is something that cannot be provided for one by others since it is essentially a matter of exercising one’s own practical reason in the pursuit of a good life. But surely others can provide for us some of the means for our exercise of practical reason—from basics such as food and shelter to more complex goods such as education and perhaps even the social bases of self-respect. If, on the other hand, human flourishing is a good in merely an agent-relative sense, then it is unclear why others’ flourishing imposes any duties on us at all—positive or negative. If duties to respect the negative rights of others are not grounded in the agent-neutral value of others’ flourishing, then presumably they must be grounded in our own flourishing, but (a) making the wrongness of harming others depend on its negative effect on us seems to make that wrongness too contingent on situational facts—surely there are some cases in which violating the rights of others can benefit us, even in the long-term holistic sense required by eudaimonistic accounts. And (b) the fact that wronging others will hurt us seems to be the wrong kind of explanation for why rights-violating acts are wrong. It seems to get matters backwards: rights-violating actions are wrong because of their effects on the person whose rights are violated, not because they detract from the rights-violator’s virtue.

b. Contractarian Libertarianism

Another moral framework that has become increasingly popular among philosophers since Rawls’s Theory of Justice (1971) is contractarianism. As a moral theory, contractarianism is the idea that moral principles are justified if and only if they are the product of a certain kind of agreement among persons. Among libertarians, this idea has been developed by Jan Narveson in his book, The Libertarian Idea (1988), which attempts to show that rational individuals would agree to a government that took individual negative liberty as the only relevant consideration in setting policy. And, while not self-described as a contractarian, Loren Lomasky’s work in Persons, Rights, and the Moral Community (1987) has many affinities with this approach, as it attempts to defend libertarianism as a kind of policy of mutual-advantage between persons.

c. Conclusion: Libertarianism as an Overlapping Consensus

Most of the libertarian theories we have surveyed in this article have a common structure: foundational philosophical commitments are set out, theories are built upon them, and practical conclusions are derived from those theories. This approach has the advantage of thoroughness—one’s ultimate political conclusions are undergirded by a weighty philosophical system to which any challengers can be directed. The downside of this approach is that anyone who disagrees with one’s philosophic foundations will not be much persuaded by one’s conclusions drawn from them—and philosophers are not generally known for their widespread agreement on foundational issues.

As a result, much of the most interesting work in contemporary libertarian theory skips systematic theory-building altogether, and heads straight to the analysis of concrete problems. Often this analysis proceeds by accepting some set of values as given—often the values embraced by those who are not sympathetic to libertarianism as a political theory—and showing that libertarian political institutions will better realize those values than competing institutional frameworks. Daniel Shapiro’s recent work on welfare states (Shapiro 2007), for instance, is a good example of this trend, in arguing that contemporary welfare states are unjustifiable from a variety of popular theoretical approaches. Loren Lomasky (2005) has written a humorous but important piece arguing that Rawls’s foundational principles are better suited to defending Nozickian libertarianism than even Nozick’s foundational principles are. And David Schmidtz (Schmidtz and Goodin 1998) has argued that market institutions are supported on grounds of individual responsibility that any moral framework ought to take seriously. While such approaches lack the theoretical completeness that philosophers naturally crave, they nevertheless have the virtue of addressing crucially important social issues in a way that dispenses with the need for complete agreement on comprehensive moral theories.

A theoretical justification of this approach can be found in John Rawls’s notion of an overlapping consensus, as developed in his work Political Liberalism (1993). Rawls’s idea is that decisions about which political institutions and principles to adopt ought to be based on those aspects of morality on which all reasonable theories converge, rather than any one particular foundational moral theory, because there is reasonable and apparently intractable disagreement about foundational moral issues. Extending this overlapping consensus approach to libertarianism, then, entails viewing libertarianism as a political theory that is compatible with a variety of foundational metaphysical, epistemological, and ethical views. Individuals need not settle their reasonable disagreements regarding moral issues in order to agree upon a framework for political association; and libertarianism, with its robust toleration of individual differences, seems well-suited to serve as the principle for such a framework (Barnett 2004).

6. References and Further Reading

  • Anderson, T. L. and Leal, D. R. Free-market Environmentalism. San Francisco: Pacific Research Institute, 1991.
    • Argues that free markets can do a better job than government regulation and management at protecting and promoting environmental goods, with detailed application to water markets, oceans, forests, and more.
  • Arneson, R. “Lockean Self-Ownership: Toward a Demolition.” Political Studies, 39 (March), 36–54, 1991.
    • A criticism of the concept of self-ownership from a contemporary liberal egalitarian philosopher. Argues that the principle is both less determinate than has been typically supposed, and that even where it has determinate implications it is unacceptable on moral grounds.
  • Barnett, R. E. The Structure of Liberty: Justice and the Rule of Law. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
    • A contemporary work of libertarian theory that weaves Hayekian insights regarding prices and information, public choice insights regarding governmental inefficiencies, and restitution-based insights on punishment arguing for a “polycentric constitutional order” (anarcho-capitalism).
  • Barnett, R. E. “The Moral Foundations of Modern Libertarianism,” in Peter Berkowitz (ed.), Varieties of Conservatism in America. Stanford: Hoover Institution Press, 2004.
    • Argues that libertarians need not choose between consequentialist and deontological foundations for their position, but can advocate it based on the idea that libertarianism’s
      support for the rule of law serves as the basis for an “overlapping consensus” of reasonable moral views.
  • Barry, N. P. On Classical Liberalism and Libertarianism. London: Macmillan, 1986.
    • A thorough and largely sympathetic survey of the major varieties of classical liberal and libertarian political thought, together with their philosophic foundations and weaknesses.
  • Berlin, I. “Two Concepts of Liberty,” in Isaiah Berlin, Four Essays on Liberty. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1990 [1958].
    • A classic defense of the political pursuit of negative over positive liberty. See, however, Rothbard’s essay “Isaiah Berlin on Negative Freedom” in The Ethics of Liberty (1982) for a libertarian criticism of this distinction and Berlin’s argument for it.
  • Buchanan, A. Ethics, Efficiency and the Market. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1985.
    • Critical survey of consequentialist, natural rights, and other deontological arguments for free markets by a first-rate philosopher.
  • Buchanan, J. and Tullock, G. The Calculus of Consent. Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press, 1962.
    • The founding text of the public choice school of political economics, which applies the assumption of rational self-interest to government agents to predict their behavior and assist in institutional design.
  • Caldwell, B. Hayek’s Challenge: An Intellectual Biography of F.A. Hayek. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2005.
    • An excellent source for biographical details of Hayek’s life, as well as a concise summary of his economic, political, social, and scientific thought, and discussion of its influence.
  • Childs, R. A. “The Invisible Hand Strikes Back.” Journal of Libertarian Studies, 1 (1), 23–33, 1977.
    • An attempt to refute Nozick’s argument that society can progress from anarchy to a minimal state by an “invisible hand” process that violates no one’s rights.
  • Childs, R. A. “Objectivism and the State: An Open Letter to Ayn Rand,” in J. K. Taylor (ed.), Liberty Against Power: Essays by Roy A. Childs, Jr. San Francisco: Fox and Wilkes, 1994 [1969].
    • Argues that Ayn Rand’s defense of a minimal state is incompatible with her more basic views regarding men’s natural rights against the initiation of force, and that a proper respect for those rights requires anarcho-capitalism.
  • Cohen, G. A. Self-ownership, Freedom, and Equality. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
    • A critical exploration of Nozick’s reliance on the concept of “self-ownership.” Cohen argues that Nozick’s libertarian conclusions do not necessarily follow from self-ownership, and that we have good reason to reject the concept anyway.
  • Epstein, R. A. Simple Rules for a Complex World. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1995.
    • An argument for a classical liberal order centered on the virtues of the simple legal rules such an order would employ. Epstein provides both a theoretical argument for the virtues of simplicity, and applications of the argument to a wide array of legal controversies.
  • Epstein, R. A. Principles for a Free Society: Reconciling Individual Liberty with the Common Good. New York: Basic Books, 1998.
    • Epstein’s most philosophical contribution to classical liberal theory, an argument based on a utilitarian justification of natural law reasoning, and a reinterpretation of Mill’s Harm Principle.
  • Epstein, R. A. Skepticism and Freedom: A Modern Case for Classical Liberalism. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2003.
    • A defense of classical liberalism from challenges of moral relativism, skepticism over legal rules, skepticism over core concepts of classical liberalism, and behavioral economics.
  • Fried, B. “Left-Libertarianissm: A Review Essay.” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 32 (1), 66–92, 2004.
    • Ostensibly a critique of the coherence and alleged “libertarianism” of contemporary left-libertarian theories. Fried’s criticisms, however, apply to many natural-rights approaches to right-libertarianism as well. See also the response piece by Vallentyne, Steiner, and Otsuka in vol. 33, no. 2, of the same journal.
  • Friedman, D. “Private Creation and Enforcement of Law: A Historical Case.” Journal of Legal Studies, 8 (2), 399–415, 1979.
    • Puts forth Medieval Iceland as a case study of a well-functioning anarchic social order.
  • Friedman, D. The Machinery of Freedom: Guide to Radical Capitalism, 2nd ed. La Salle: Open Court, 1989.
    • A utilitarian defense of anarcho-capitalism. The second condition also contains a valuable postscript that discusses problems for non-utilitarian defenses of libertarianism.
  • Friedman, M. Capitalism and Freedom. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1962.
    • Argues that economic freedom and political freedom are intimately connected, and presents the case for free markets and voluntary action in education, poverty relief, occupational licensure, and more. A classic.
  • Gaus, G. “Hayek on the Evolution of Society and Mind,” in E. Feser (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Hayek. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
    • A systematic exploration of the concept of “evolution” as employed in Hayek’s social and economic thought, and in his philosophy of mind. Defends Hayek’s use of the concept against criticisms that it is normatively vacuous or that it fails to justify a market order.
  • Gaus, G. “Social Complexity and Evolved Moral Principles,” in P. McNamara (ed.), Liberalism, Conservatism, and Hayek’s Idea of Spontaneous Order. London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2007.
    • An exploration and defense of the Hayekian idea that because of the complexity of social orders, governments should adhere to abstract moral principles rather than violating those principles and seeking to promote expedient outcomes.
  • Hardin, G. “The Tragedy of the Commons.” Science,162, 1243–1248, 1968.
    • The classic statement of the tragedy of the commons. Hardin, however, draws the distinctively un-libertarian conclusion that because the carrying capacity of the earth as a whole is a commons, freedom to reproduce must be severely coercively curtailed if overpopulation and its attendant problems are to be avoided.
  • Hasnas, J. “Reflections on the Minimal State.” Politics, Philosophy and Economics, 2 (1), 115–128, 2003.
    • Argues that public-good arguments for the state provision of law and law enforcement fail, since the state can ensure such goods are provided without providing them itself. Hence, even if they were valid, public good arguments would not justify the “minimal state,” but something smaller.
  • Hasnas, J. “The Obviousness of Anarchy,” in R. Long and T. Machan (eds.), Anarchism/Minarchism: Is Government Part of a Free Country? United Kingdom: Ashgate Press, 2007.
    • Argues that anarchism’s feasibility can be demonstrated by surveying a number of contemporary and historical examples where the goods that government is thought to be necessary to provide have been or are provided by voluntary means.
  • Hayek, F. A. The Constitution of Liberty. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1960.
    • The early statement of Hayek’s social theory, later developed in more detail in his Law, Legislation, and Liberty series. This book presents Hayek’s theory of freedom, coercion, and law, presents a defense of a classical liberal social order, and discusses the problems involved in modern welfare states.
  • Hayek, F. A. Law, Legislation and Liberty. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1973.
    • This three volume series represents the fullest development of Hayek’s social and political thought, applying his concepts of dispersed knowledge and spontaneous order to the phenomena of law and justice.
  • Hayek, F. A. “The Use of Knowledge in Society,” in F. Hayek (ed.), Individualism and Economic Order. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1980 [1945].
    • Hayek’s seminal paper discussing the way in which a free price system serves to convey information and coordinate social action.
  • Hayek, F. A. and Bartley III, W. W. The Fatal Conceit: The Errors of Socialism. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1988.
    • Presents Hayek’s theory of the origins and evolution of modern society, his defense of a form of liberal traditionalism, and his critique of political rationalism, especially as it manifests itself in socialism.
  • Kirzner, I. The Meaning of Market Process. New York: Routledge, 1996.
    • A collection of essays by one of the world’s leading Austrian economists. This book focuses on the role of ignorance, uncertainty, and time in market competition, and the role of the entrepreneur in the continual (but always incomplete) move toward equilibrium.
  • Klein, D. and Fielding, G. J. “Private Toll Roads: Learning from the Nineteenth Century.” Transportation Quarterly, 7 (July), 321–341, 1992.
    • Discusses how roads, considered by many economists to be a classic public good, were provided on a fee-for-use basis in the nineteenth century, and what lessons can be learned from this example for contemporary transportation policy.
  • Kukathas, C. Hayek and Modern Liberalism. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989.
    • A sympathetic but critical appraisal of Hayek’s social thought by a contemporary libertarian political theorist.
  • Kukathas, C. “The Mirage of Global Justice.” Social Philosophy and Policy, 23 (1), 1–28, 2006.
    • A libertarian contribution to the debate on international justice, this paper argues that the political pursuit of global justice is an unworthy goal, and that the design of international institutions should be aimed at limiting power rather than securing justice.
  • Locke, J. The Second Treatise of Government. New York: MacMillan, 1952 [1689].
    • Locke’s classic statement of his positive political philosophy, which expounds upon the ideas of natural law, property rights, and limited governments.
  • Lomasky, L. E. Persons, Rights, and the Moral Community. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1987.
    • A thorough and unique philosophical defense of classical liberalism, based on the idea that agents require liberty to pursue projects that matter to them, and must grant liberty to others to expect it themselves.
  • Lomasky, L. E. “Libertarianism at Twin Harvard.” Social Philosophy and Policy, 22 (1), 178–199, 2005.
    • A playful piece that paints a picture of Twin Harvard (on Twin Earth) where Rawls is a libertarian and Nozick a welfare-state liberal, which suggests that Twin-Rawls and Twin-Nozick just might be more consistent than their real-world counterparts.
  • Mack, E. “Self-ownership, Marxism, and Egalitarianism: Part I: Challenges to Historical Entitlement.” Politics, Philosophy and Economics, 1 (1), 75–108, 2002a.
    • A response to Cohen’s criticism of Nozick, this piece defends the idea that rights to self-ownership legitimately yield unequal distributions of income and wealth.
  • Mack, E. “Self-ownership, Marxism, and Egalitarianism: Part II: Challenges to the Self-ownership Thesis.” Politics, Philosophy and Economics, 1 (2), 237–276, 2002b.
    • This second part of Mack’s response to Cohen defends the self-ownership thesis against his criticisms.
  • Mack, E. and Gaus, G. “Classical Liberalism and Libertarianism: The Liberty Tradition,” in G. Gaus and C. Kukathas (eds.), Handbook of Political Theory. London: Sage, 2004.
    • A helpful discussion of classical liberalism and libertarianism, which focuses on the various commitments these theories share, and how their disagreement about the centrality or validity of some of these commitments divides the various members of this intellectual tradition.
  • Mill, J. S. “On Liberty,”in Stefan Collini (ed.), On Liberty and Other Writings. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989 [1859].
    • Mill’s classic statement of the moral foundations of liberalism. Mill famously argues that each person should be at liberty to do as he wills so long as he does not harm others in doing so. One of the most influential defenses of individuality, free thought, and expression in the Western canon.
  • Mitchell, W. and Simmons, R. Beyond Politics: Markets, Welfare, and the Failure of Bureaucracy. San Francisco: Westview Press, 1994.
    • An accessible primer on public choice theory, with special focus on its implications for advocates of limited government.
  • Murray, C. Losing Ground: American Social Policy, 1950–1980. New York: Basic Books, 1984.
    • Argues that the growth of welfare in 1960s and 1970s America worsened the lot of poor and minority citizens, largely by eroding their incentive and ability to take responsibility for their lives.
  • Nagel, T. “Libertarianism Without Foundations.” Yale Law Journal, 85, 136–149, 1975.
    • Argues that Nozick’s defense of libertarianism is entirely unsuccessful insofar as it fails to provide a defense of the robust conception of individual rights that supports it.
  • Narveson, J. The Libertarian Idea. Philadelphia: Temple University Press, 1988.
    • A contractarian defense of libertarianism, inspired by the work of David Gauthier and Robert Nozick. Discusses both libertarian theory and its application to current controversies such as children’s rights, zoning laws, and national defense.
  • Nozick, R. Anarchy, State, and Utopia. New York: Basic Books, 1974.
    • Nozick’s classic statement of libertarian principles. Highlights include a lengthy criticism of Rawls’s Theory of Justice, and a neglected third section on how a libertarian society serves as a “framework for utopia.”
  • Otsuka, M. Libertarianism Without Inequality. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2003.
    • One of the most recent systematic developments of left-libertarianism, combining individual rights to full self-ownership with the egalitarian principle of equal opportunity for welfare.
  • Otteson, J. Actual Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
    • A Kantian defense of classical liberalism, centered on the idea of respect for persons, and developed with an Aristotelian conception of judgment.
  • Rand, A. “Man’s Rights,” in A. Rand, The Virtue of Selfishness. New York: Signet, 1963a.
  • Rand, A. “The Nature of Government,” in A. Rand, The Virtue of Selfishness. New York: Signet, 1963b.
    • These two essays provide the core statement of Rand’s political philosophy. While rejecting the label “libertarian,” Rand here advocates a minimal state that uses force only in retaliation as the only political system compatible with man’s rational nature.
  • Rasmussen, D. B. and Den Uyl, D. J. Liberty and Nature: An Aristotelian Defense of Liberal Order. La Salle: Open Court, 1991.
    • Drawing some inspiration from Rand’s work, this text is one of the most thoroughgoing applications of Aristotelian moral philosophy to the defense of natural law and classical liberalism.
  • Rasmussen, D.B. and Den Uyl, D. J. Norms of Liberty: A Perfectionist Basis for Non-Perfectionist Politics. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, 2005.
    • A development of their earlier work, this view provides a more foundational defense for the authors’ Aristotelian version of classical liberalism, and defends the view against communitarian and conservative critics.
  • Rawls, J. Political Liberalism. New York: Columbia University Press, 1993.
    • Rawls’s classic expansion of his thoughts on domestic justice, following his seminal work A Theory of Justice (1971).
  • Rothbard, M. N. “Robert Nozick and the Immaculate Conception of the State.” Journal of Libertarian Studies, 1 (1), 45–57, 1977.
    • Defends the anarcho-capitalist position against Nozick’s arguments in the first part of Anarchy, State, and Utopia.
  • Rothbard, M. N. For a New Liberty. New York: Collier, 1978.
    • Rothbard’s most accessible book, this volume sets out a natural rights basis for anarcho-capitalism. While weak in foundational moral theory, the volume provides a number of ingenious discussions of how a stateless society cold solve many pressing social and economic problems.
  • Rothbard, M. N. The Ethics of Liberty. New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1982.
    • This book explores many of the themes of Rothbard’s For a New Liberty in greater theoretical depth. It develops Rothbard’s theory of liberty, shows how it is incompatible with even a minimal state, and contrasts his position with those of von Mises, Hayek, and Robert Nozick.
  • Schmidtz, D. Elements of Justice. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
    • Develops a pluralist account of justice based on considerations of desert, reciprocity, equality, and need, and shows how a classical liberal conception of the state is sensitive to this wide array of moral concerns.
  • Schmidtz, D. and Goodin, R. Social Welfare and Individual Responsibility. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
    • Part of Cambridge University Press’s “For and Against” series, this volume has Schmidtz presenting the case for limited government involvement in the promotion of individual welfare via market regulation and redistribution, and Goodin presenting the case for a more active welfare state. A very accessible and useful volume.
  • Shapiro, D. Is the Welfare State Justified? Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
    • Draws heavily on empirical research to argue that none of the dominant positions in contemporary political philosophy—egalitarianism, positive rights theory, communitarianism, and so on—support contemporary central welfare state institutions.
  • Skoble, A. Deleting the State.New York: Open Court Press, 2008.
    • An extended contemporary treatment of the case for anarcho-capitalism, arguing that centralized coercive political authority is incompatible with the value of liberty.
  • Smith, A. An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations, 2 vols. Indianapolis: Liberty Fund, 1981 [1776].
    • One of the most historically important statements of the economic case for free exchange. Smith’s book remains a masterful statement of both the strengths and weaknesses of a market economy.
  • Steiner, H. An Essay on Rights. New York: Blackwell, 1994.
    • Sets forward a libertarian theory of rights that protect each individual’s claim to self-ownership, but which allows for the redistribution of external goods. An influential left-libertarian work in the Lockean tradition of natural rights.
  • Thornton, M. The Economics of Prohibition. Salt Lake City: University of Utah Press, 1991.
    • An application of the Austrian theory of economics to the issue of drug and alcohol prohibition, which argues that all such prohibitions should be repealed.
  • Vallentyne, P. “Left-Libertarianism: A Primer,” in P. Vallentyne and H. Steiner (eds.), Left Libertarianism and its Critics: The Contemporary Debate. New York: Palgrave, 2000.
    • A useful overview of the core commitments of left-libertarianism, its historical origins and contemporary development, and its responses to common objections.
  • von Mises, L. Socialism: An Economic and Sociological Analysis. J. Kahane (transl.). Indianapolis: Liberty Fund, 1981 [1922].
    • A thorough critique of socialism from one of the leading figures in Austrian economics. Contains Mises’s famous argument that economic calculation in a purely socialist society is impossible, given its lack of a free price system to convey information about relative supply and demand.
  • Waldron, J. “Two Worries About Mixing One’s Labour.” The Philosophical Quarterly, 33 (130), 37–44, 1983.
    • Argues that the Lockean idea of mixing one’s labor with external property is incoherent and adds nothing to whatever other arguments Locke might have for the justification of private property.

Author Information

Matt Zwolinski
Email: mzwolinski@sandiego.edu
University of San Diego
U. S. A.

Thomas Hobbes: Methodology

hobbesThomas Hobbes (1588-1679) is one of England’s most influential political philosophers. According to his own estimation, he was probably the most important philosopher of his time, if not of history, since he believed himself to be the first to discover a genuine “science of politics.” Modeled on the surefire method of geometry, his political science was supposed to demonstrate political truths with the certainty of a geometric proof. Such a science was desperately needed by his fellow English citizens, Hobbes believed, because political disagreements and conflicts were tearing apart his country. According to Hobbes, civil war is primarily caused by differing opinions over who is the ultimate political authority in a commonwealth. In his own time, the King’s claim of having the final say on political matters was called into question by members of Parliament. For example, when King Charles tried to raise funds for a war against Spain and France in 1626, Parliament denied his request. In response, the King used a “forced loan” to force individual subjects to finance his needs. This action contributed to the rising tensions between King and Parliament, tensions that ultimately erupted in civil war. According to Hobbes, the only way to escape civil war and to maintain a state of peace in a commonwealth is to institute an impartial and absolute sovereign power that is the final authority on all political issues. Hobbes believes his own political philosophy scientifically proves such a conclusion. If Hobbes’s political argument is as sound as a geometric proof, then his own estimation of his philosophical importance may not be exaggerated.

Table of Contents

  1. History and Politics: The Political Problem
    1. Hobbes’s Translation of Thucydides
    2. Hobbes’s History of the English Civil War
    3. Hobbes’s Philosophy of Law
  2. Scientific Views
    1. Philosophical Method: Resolution and Composition
    2. Scientific Demonstration
    3. Motion and Science
    4. Geometry and Physics
  3. Philosophy of Human Nature
    1. Hobbes’s Moral Philosophy
    2. The State of Nature
  4. Science of Politics
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. History and Politics: The Political Problem

Hobbes presented his “science of politics” as a response to a specific historical situation characterized by acute political problems. This science of politics is primarily found in Hobbes’s “political works,” as they may be called, which include The Elements of Law (1640), De Cive (1642) and Leviathan (1651). Although these texts provide detailed insight into Hobbes’s solution to civil war, they provide only a general understanding of the problem itself. Hobbes’s so-called historical treatises, on the other hand, reveal the specific causes of the deteriorating political situation in seventeenth century England. These works include his translation of Thucydides’ History of the Peloponnesian Wars (1628), Behemoth (1668) and A Dialogue between a Philosopher and a Student of the Common Laws of England (1669). As some Hobbes scholars have pointed out, there is a logical priority to Hobbes’s political works because they provide solutions to the problems presented in the historical works. To gain a better appreciation of Hobbes’s political solution, then, it is useful to first summarize his historical works, which reveal his understanding of the particular problem he faced.

a. Hobbes’s Translation of Thucydides

Hobbes’s decision to translate and publish Thucydides’ history in 1628 was certainly a reaction to the growing political tensions in England at this time. In the 1620s, troubles between Charles I and Parliament escalated due to the King’s insistence on raising funds for as series of unpopular wars. After the King openly declared war on Spain, he began to amass the largest military entourage since 1588. For a variety of reasons, including early losses suffered at Cadiz at the hands of the Spanish and the negative effects of war on trade, Parliament was reluctant to grant additional funds to the King. This situation was compounded by a progressively deteriorating relationship with France. France’s own maritime conflicts led to embargoes that created more barriers to international trade. Furthermore, tensions between England and France increased on account of France’s continued possession of English ships (which were originally on loan) and because of long-simmering religious differences between the two nations. After the Parliament of 1626 denied Charles’ request for supply, the King raised funds through a forced loan, by which private individuals were made to loan money to the crown. Such actions not only strained the relationship between the Parliament and King, but also revealed a number of ideological differences between these two centers of power with serious political implications. The most important issue concerned the King’s authority and its relationship to the law. Charles advocated a divine right theory of kingship according to which God granted him the power, by the grace of his royal anointment, to act outside the law at his own prerogative. The King tempered his view by claiming he would take extra-legal actions only when necessary and only for the good of the commonwealth. Despite this claim of self-restraint, some of his actions conflicted with his declaration of good faith. The King’s insistence on the right to imprison outside the law, for example, sparked serious doubts as to whether his word could be trusted. The Petition of Right, presented in Parliament in 1628, attempted to preserve the liberties of the subjects against the threatening actions of the King, such as forced loans, extra-legal imprisonment, and the billeting of soldiers. Religious differences, as well as politics, were partly to blame for the political problems of Hobbes’ England. It was well understood that religious leaders were not always content with some of the policies of the crown. English Protestants, including both traditional Anglicans and the more radical Puritans, for example, were highly suspicious of Charles’ fervent support of the Anglican Archbishop Laud. The primary reason for their reservations was Laud’s advocacy of certain anti-Calvinist notions, including the view that the elect could fall from God’s grace through sin. Such a view questioned the bedrock Calvinist notion of predestination to which most English Protestants adhered. In effect, Charles asserted his right as king to declare the traditional position and dictate orthodox dogma by supporting his Archbishop. Historical circumstances strongly suggest that Hobbes’s translation of Thucydides was meant to be a political argument for the royalist cause. Hobbes himself supports the truth of this when he states that Thucydides’ history provides instruction useful for the defense of the King. But what specific lessons does this ancient history hold? Hobbes believes democracy is inadequate partly because common people are easily swayed towards politically destructive actions by “demagogues” and religious zealots. If political power is placed in the hands of the common people, who are under the influence of power hungry individuals seeking their own advantage, then the commonwealth will likely fall. Hobbes’s publication of Thucydides was a political act meant to support the royalist cause and to warn against the dangerous consequences of usurping the King’s power.

b. Hobbes’s History of the English Civil War

In Behemoth, Hobbes shows his readers that an ideological dispute concerning politics and religion was the root cause of the English Civil War. The work begins with a simple question: How did King Charles I, a strong and capable leader, lose the sovereign power that he held by the legal right of succession? The initial answer is that the King lost control of the kingdom because he lacked the financial resources required to maintain a military. Upon further consideration, however, Hobbes reveals that a deeper cause of conflict was the fact that the “people were corrupted” by “seducers” to accept opinions and beliefs contrary to social and political harmony. Hobbes claims that religious leaders were mostly to blame for creating dissension in the commonwealth because they are responsible for the dissemination of politically dangerous beliefs. In addition, Hobbes placed some of the blame on Aristotle or, more precisely, on religious and political leaders who misused Aristotelian ideas to their own advantage. As noted above, Hobbes had suggested the dangerous consequences of religious fervor in his translation of Thucydides. In Behemoth, religious leaders directly bear the brunt of his critical remarks. According to Hobbes, religious leaders sow disorder by creating situations of divided loyalty between God and King. Hobbes first blamed Presbyterian preachers for using rhetorical tricks to capture the minds and loyalties of their parishioners. These preachers did not instill beliefs by using reason or argument, nor did they necessarily seek to teach people to understand. Instead, they indoctrinated their listeners with seditious principles. For Hobbes, preachers are actors who bedazzle their audience by claiming to be divinely inspired. Many “fruitless and dangerous doctrines,” Hobbes says, are adopted by people because they are “terrified and amazed by preachers” (B 252). In short, preachers used the word of God as a means to undermine the lawful authority of the King. Hobbes also criticized Catholics for their belief that the Pope should reign over the spiritual lives of the people. Although the Pope’s power is supposed to operate solely within the realm of religious faith and morality, papal orders frequently bled over into the world of politics. The problem, for Hobbes, is that the Pope may extend his power over spiritual concerns to the point where it infringes upon and restricts the legitimate scope of the King’s power over civil matters. The most dangerous problem with Catholicism, for example, is the Pope’s self-proclaimed right to absolve the duties of citizens to “heretic” Kings. In Behemoth, Hobbes also launches an attack on Independents, Anabaptists, Quakers, and Adamites for their role in creating civil discontent. These religious groups, discontented with both Protestantism and Catholicism, encouraged individuals to read and interpret the Bible for themselves. The result was that “every man became a judge of religion, and an interpreter of the Scriptures” and so “they thought they spoke with God Almighty, and understood what he said” (B 190). The private, antinomian interpretation of Scripture, Hobbes claims, frequently lead to situations of divided loyalty between God and King. If individuals may speak with God directly, then each person may decide for him or herself what civil laws are contrary to God’s word, and thereby what laws may be justly broken. Furthermore, Hobbes indirectly blames Aristotle for problems in his country when he criticizes the destructive use of Aristotelian metaphysical and ethical ideas. Hobbes points out, for example, that priests used Aristotelian philosophy to explain their power to transform a piece of bread into the “body of Christ.” The notion of the transubstantiation of the Eucharist, according to Hobbes, gives the impression that priests deserve reverence because they possess godly powers. Priests exploited the metaphysical doctrines of Aristotle to convince people “there is but one way to salvation, that is, extraordinary devotion and liberality to the Church, and a readiness for the Church’s sake, if it be required, to fight against their natural and lawful sovereign” (B 215). In the same vein, Hobbes points out that Aristotle’s ethical ideas were used to undermine the legitimacy of the sovereign power. According to Aristotle’s doctrine of the mean, to determine what is virtuous in a particular situation one must find the middle path between two extremes. In Hobbes’s opinion, this leaded individuals to determine for themselves what is right or wrong in a given situation. The political problem with this view, as might be expected, is that it leads to questioning the validity and regulatory power of civil law, and it thereby could foster resistance and rebellion.

c. Hobbes’s Philosophy of Law

In A Dialogue between a Philosopher and a Student of the Common Laws of England, Hobbes claims that common law lawyers, such as Sir Edward Coke, are partly to blame for the civil strife in England. According to Coke, the King is legally restricted by the common law, which is a set of laws determined and refined over the course of time by the application of an ‘artificial reason’ possessed by wise lawyers and judges. Hobbes agrees with Coke that reason plays an important part in law, but argues that the King’s reason is responsible for determining the meaning of laws. In the political situation prior to the outbreak of civil war, this philosophical difference revealed itself when the King requested funds and was denied. Hobbes, as we have seen, believed the immediate cause of Charles’ inability to maintain the sovereign power was his lack of funds to support a military. Charles’ request was denied on the basis, in part, of certain statutes claiming that kings shall not levy taxes or enact other means of funding without the common consent of the realm. The interpretation of these statutes according to the ‘reason’ of the lawyers in Parliament, Hobbes says, is partly to blame for the King’s failure to acquire needed funding. As with the religious seducers, common law lawyers often created situations of divided loyalty. In their interpretation of the law, barristers such as Coke sometimes claimed the ‘law’ is in conflict with the dictates of the King. In such situations, is one’s duty of obedience to the law (as interpreted by the ‘wise men’ of Parliament) higher than one’s duty to the King? These kinds of questions, Hobbes believes, inevitably lead to division in the commonwealth and this, in turn, leads to factions within the body politic and civil discord.

2. Scientific Views

Hobbes’s “science of politics” was supposed to provide a solution to the ideological conflicts that lead to civil war by providing a method of achieving consensus on political matters. If the conflicting parties could ultimately agree on political ideas, then peace and prosperity in the commonwealth could be achieved. Hobbes’s aim was to put politics onto a scientific footing and thereby establish an enduring state of peace. To understand Hobbes’s idea of science one needs to turn to De Corpore (or On the Body), which is his most developed text on scientific ideas. In this manuscript of natural philosophy, Hobbes presents his views on philosophical method, mathematics, geometry, physics, and human nature. In his own opinion, the views contained in De Corpore represented the foundational principles of his entire philosophical system and, therefore, of his “science of politics.”

a. Philosophical Method: Resolution and Composition

Hobbes, like many of his contemporaries, stresses the importance of having a proper philosophical method for attaining knowledge. In contrast to the reliance on authority that was typical of medieval scholasticism, leading intellectuals and scientists of Hobbes’s time believed that knowledge is not attained by appealing to authority, but by employing an appropriately objective method. For Hobbes, such a method was not only important for attaining knowledge, but also served the practical end of avoiding disputes which arose from speculation and subjective interpretation. Although Hobbes did not consistently describe his philosophical methodology, most scholars agree that he used a “resolutive-compositive” method. According to this method, one comes to understand a given object of inquiry by intellectually “resolving” it into its constituent parts and then subsequently “composing” it back into a whole. For Hobbes, such a process may be used when investigating a natural body (such as a chair or a man), an abstract body (such as a circle), or a political body (such as a commonwealth). So, to use Hobbes’s example, one can intellectually resolve the idea of a human being into the following ideas: “rational,” “animated,” and “body.” On the other hand, one can compose the idea of a man by reconstructing these concepts. In the process of resolving and composing a thing, one is able to discover its essential qualities. This process is analogous to taking apart a watch and putting it back together again to find out what makes it tick. Hobbes used the method of resolution and composition in his science of politics. He first resolved the commonwealth into its parts (that is, human beings), and then resolved these parts into their parts (i.e. the motions of natural bodies), and then resolved these into their parts (that is, abstract figures). After such a resolution, Hobbes recomposed the commonwealth in his grand trilogy that progressed from the abstract and physical investigation of natural bodies, to the study of human bodies, to finally the examination of political bodies.

b. Scientific Demonstration

It was important for Hobbes not only to acquire knowledge for himself, but also to demonstrate his conclusions to others. According to Hobbes, scientific demonstration is a linguistic activity of constructing syllogisms out of propositions, which themselves are constructed out of names. The basic linguistic unit of scientific demonstration, then, is the “name.” Hobbes believes that names may be used either as “marks,” which recall certain thoughts to our minds, or as “signs,” which communicate our thoughts to others. One may, for example, use the name “man” as a mark, or mnemonic device, to remember what a man is, or one may use the name to communicate something about men to others. When two or more names are joined with a copula (an “is”), a proposition is created. For example, “man is an animal” is a proposition that joins “man” with “animal.” A syllogism is a series of three propositions where the first two (that is, the premises) logically support the third (that is, the conclusion). From the two premises “men are animals” and “animals are alive,” for example, one may logically conclude that, “men are alive.” This is how one constructs syllogisms out of propositions. Scientific demonstration, however, is not simply a matter of logically deducing conclusions; the conclusions must also be universal and true. According to Hobbes, a universal conclusion is one that attributes a characteristic to an entire class of things. For example, “all human beings are rational” is a statement in which the term “rational” is used to describe all humans. Hobbes continues, if the predicate term in such a statement ‘comprehends’ the subject term, then the statement is also a true one. For example, in the statement “Human beings are animals,” the subject term (“human beings”) is included within the predicate term (“animals”) and so is a true statement. A scientific demonstration, then, is a syllogism that deduces universal and true propositions on the basis of premises with the same characteristics. (Interestingly, in geometry, which is Hobbes’s paradigm of scientific demonstration, the truth of the first principles is established by agreement. In this case, Hobbes adheres to a “conventional view of truth,” according to which the truth of propositions is determined by consensus.)

c. Motion and Science

It is not possible to speak of Hobbes’s view of science without referring to the concept of motion. Hobbes believes that motion, understood as any kind of change, is the universal cause of all things. The various branches of science, therefore, are ultimately sciences of motion. For example, Hobbes believes that geometry is a science of motion because it involves the construction of figures through the movement of points. Physics, similarly, is the science that studies the motion of physical bodies. Even moral philosophy is a science of motion because it studies the “motions of the mind” (such as envy, greed, and selfishness) that cause human actions. Thus, one may discover the motions, or actions, that lead to the creation of a commonwealth by understanding the “motions” of the human mind in a parallel way as when one studies points and physical bodies.

d. Geometry and Physics

After presenting his ideas on philosophical method in the first part of De Corpore, Hobbes applies this method to both the abstract world of geometry and to the real and existing world of physical objects. Keeping to his goal of scientifically demonstrating his conclusions, Hobbes begins his geometrical investigations with a number of foundational definitions, including those of space, time and bodies; he uses these definitions to compose an abstract world of geometric figures and then to draw a number of conclusions about them. At the end of Part III, the investigation shifts away from the abstract world to the ‘real and existent’ one, signifying a shift from geometry to physics. At the start of his physical investigations, Hobbes reiterates his point that resolution and composition are the methods to obtain philosophical knowledge. The appropriate method for scientifically investigating the natural world, Hobbes says, is resolution. The goal of physics is to understand the motions of the world as experienced by us. Since our knowledge of the physical world comes from our experiences, Hobbes believes the first job of physics is to analyze the faculty of sense. Hobbes resolves human sensation into its various “parts”: the sense organs, the faculties of imagination and fancy, and the sensations of pleasure and pain. Hobbes then resolves natural bodies, starting with a resolution of the “whole” world, to unveil the variety of motions responsible for physical phenomena, such as the motion of the stars, the change of seasons, the presence of heat and color, and the power of gravity. All of these natural phenomena are explained, just as geometric figures are, in terms of bodies in motion. Important differences between geometry and physics surface in Hobbes’s De Corpore. In the first case, Hobbes uses a compositive method in geometry. Starting with definitions of lines and points, Hobbes derives a number of conclusions about the world of geometric figures. In his physics, on the other hand, Hobbes starts by resolving senses and the phenomena provided by them. There is also a second distinction that concerns the truth or falsity of claims made in each science. According to Hobbes, geometry operates within the realm of truth because it is grounded on primary principles, or definitions, that are known as true because they have been accepted as true. The principles of physics, on the other hand, are hypothetical because they are not agreed upon initially, but are discovered through observation. The difference in the demonstrable nature of physics and geometry is ultimately based upon their contrasting methodologies.

3. Philosophy of Human Nature

The second part of Hobbes’s trilogy, which investigates human bodies, follows physics, which studies natural bodies. The point of transition between physics and the study of human nature is found in what may be called Hobbes’s “philosophy of mind” or “psychology.” Moral philosophy is a part of physics because the motion of material bodies on our sense organs, which is the subject matter of physics, causes a variety of motions in the human mind. While moral philosophy is technically a part of physics, it may also be seen as the starting point for political philosophy insofar as it lays down the foundational ethical principles from which social conclusions are derived. Hobbes’s scientific methodology is apparent in the political argument of Leviathan. Following the method of resolution, Hobbes resolves the commonwealth into its fundamental “parts,” i.e. humans, and further resolves humans into their “parts,” i.e., motions of the mind. Hobbes’s political argument in Leviathan, then, begins with his views on the nature of the mind and human psychology. After studying human individuals in isolation, he reconstructs the commonwealth by placing them in a state of nature, an abstract condition prior to the formation of political society. By analyzing the behavior, or “motions,” of humans in this controlled environment, Hobbes believes he has discovered the causes of commonwealths. At the same time that Hobbes uses the compositive method to intellectually reconstruct the commonwealth, he also tries to demonstrate his political conclusions following the paradigm of geometry by defining fundamental features of human nature and then drawing conclusions on the basis of these. It should be noted that Hobbes is not always consistent or rigorous in applying a scientific method to political matters. In the Introduction to Leviathan, for example, Hobbes claims that self-inspection is the primary method for understanding his political ideas. In this case, the foundational principles of his political science are not derived from physics, but are known simply by reflecting on one’s experiences. In addition, Hobbes claimed that the second part of his trilogy, De Cive, was published first because it relied on its own empirical principles. Furthermore, in Leviathan, especially the early chapters, Hobbes uses many rhetorical devices in getting his point across, rather than following a strict pattern of deriving conclusions from definitions and fundamental principles. Such devices probably indicate that Hobbes was aiming at a wider readership with this work, with possible political implications.

a. Hobbes’s Moral Philosophy

Hobbes’s masterpiece in political philosophy begins with a study of human individuals and the “motions” of their “parts.” In the early chapters of Leviathan, Hobbes advocates a mechanistic and materialist psychology. He claims that the motions of external physical objects on sense organs cause a variety of mental experiences in the mind, which Hobbes refers to as “fancies” or “appearances”; such mental phenomena ultimately cause human behavior. As Hobbes sees it, the movement of external objects lead to the production of mental motions called “endeavours,” which are of two types: appetites and aversions. An appetite is an endeavour that causes an individual to seek out a particular object. An aversion, on the other hand, is an endeavor that causes one to avoid an object. For Hobbes, individuals naturally have an appetite for the “good,” which he defines simply as the object of one’s appetite. In other words, if a person desires an object, that object is “good” for that person. When deciding how to act in a particular situation, humans must “deliberate” by weighing appetites and aversions. Individuals will necessarily choose the act that apparently produces the greatest good for the individual concerned. Deliberation, therefore, is not as much a matter of choice as it is the result of a mechanical process.

b. The State of Nature

Hobbes’s psychological observations in the early chapters of Leviathan are about human individuals, not community members. Following the compositive aspect of his methodology, Hobbes “combines” individuals in a state of nature, a state prior to the formation of the commonwealth. In the “natural condition of mankind,” humans are equal, despite minor differences in strength and mental acuity. Hobbes’s notion of equality is peculiar in that it refers to the equal ability to kill or conquer one another, but quite consistent with his notion of power. This equality, Hobbes says, naturally leads to conflict among individuals for three reasons: competition, distrust, and glory. In the first case, if two individuals desire a scarce commodity, they will compete for the commodity and necessarily become enemies. In their efforts to acquire desired objects, each person tries to “destroy or subdue” the other. On account of the constant fear produced in the state of nature, Hobbes believes, it is reasonable to distrust others and use preemptive strikes against one’s enemies. Hobbes also considers humans to be naturally vainglorious and so seek to dominate others and demand their respect. The natural condition of mankind, according to Hobbes, is a state of war in which life is “solitary, poor, nasty, brutish, and short” because individuals are in a “war of all against all” (L 186). In such a state, Hobbes contends that individuals have a “natural right” to do whatever they believe is necessary to preserve their lives. In other words, individuals in the state of nature are not constrained by moral or legal obligations as neither could exist prior to the establishment of a commonwealth. In the state of nature “nothing can be Unjust’ since the ‘notions of Right and Wrong, Justice and Injustice have there no place” (L 188). Human liberty, for Hobbes, is simply the freedom of bodily action and is not limited by any moral or legal notions. A person is free, in other words, when not physically confined or imprisoned. Because the state of nature is a state of continuous and comprehensive war, Hobbes claims it is necessary and rational for individuals to seek peace to satisfy their desires, including the natural desire for self-preservation. The human power of reason, Hobbes says, reveal the “laws of nature” that enable humans to establish a state of peace and escape the horrors of the state of nature.

4. Science of Politics

The geometric method is nowhere more apparent in Hobbes’s political philosophy than in his treatment of the laws of nature. Definitions are provided and a series of conclusions are drawn in rapid fashion; there is a deep logical consistency to its prudential outcomes. Hobbes begins by defining laws of nature as rational precepts that lead individuals toward a state of peace. The first law of nature is that every person should seek peace with others, unless others are not willing to cooperate, in which case one may use the “helps of war.” This law of nature has two parts to it. In the first part, it encourages a state of peace by instructing individuals to satisfy their desire for self-preservation. Yet, because peaceful coexistence requires reciprocity, if only one party seeks peace, it is unlikely it will be established. For this reason, there is a second part to the first law of nature; that is, if others are not interested in settling the conflict, one must resort to violent action to secure one’s survival. Humans, as we have seen, have a natural right to determine what is necessary for their own individual survival. The existence of this natural right often promotes a state of war, so peace requires that individuals renounce or transfer this right in part or in whole. From the first law of nature, then, Hobbes derives a second law according to which individuals must lay down their natural rights universally and concurrently in order to obtain peace. A natural right is relinquished either by transferring a right to a specific recipient or by renouncing the right entirely. In order to escape the war of all against all, Hobbes claims, a common power must be established by a mutual transference of right to protect the individuals not only from foreign invaders, but also from each other. Yet, since the object of one’s voluntary actions is some good to oneself, a person can never abandon or transfer their right to self-preservation. The purpose of establishing a common power is to escape from the condition of war, a condition that seriously threatens each person’s conservation, which is one’s highest good. Thus, a person cannot give up the natural right to self-preservation or to the means of self-preservation. According to the second law of nature, then, we must transfer those rights whose exercise contributes to civil conflict. This leads to the third law of nature stating that individuals must abide by any covenants consented to freely. For a common power to perform the task for which it is erected, it is necessary that individuals follow through on their mutual agreements. In Leviathan, Hobbes deduces sixteen more laws of nature, all of which aim at maintaining the state of peace established by the erection of a common power. These laws provide a code of moral behavior by prohibiting socially destructive behavior or attitudes, such as drunkenness or ingratitude. The political consequence of the laws of nature is the institution of a political body that makes possible a state of peace. Hobbes claims the sovereign power may reside in one person or an assembly, so that a singular type of government is not required to maintain the peace. It is necessary, however, for the sovereign power to possess certain rights to fulfill the task for which it was established. In a manner similar to the deduction of the laws of nature, Hobbes derives the rights and powers of sovereignty. In this derivation, Hobbes deduces those rights that are necessary for maintaining peace. To give one example, the sovereign power has the right not to be dissolved by its subjects Hobbes derives eleven other rights; if any of the rights are granted away, Hobbes asserts, the commonwealth will revert to a state of war. The rights, briefly put, entail a defense of political absolutism. According to the basic tenets of Hobbes’s political absolutism, the sovereign power enacts and enforces all laws, determines when to make war and peace, controls the military, judges all doctrines and opinions, decides all controversies between citizens, chooses its own counselors and ministers, and cannot be legitimately resisted, except in rare instances (that is, when it cannot guarantee the peace and security of its subjects—that is, it loses “the power of the sword”). The “science of politics,” as presented in Hobbes’s political works, offers a solution to the specific problems he addressed in his historical works. The essence of his solution is “political absolutism,” according to which the sovereign is the final arbiter on all matters ethical, religious, and political. One of the “diseases of a commonwealth,” Hobbes says, is the opinion that “every private man is Judge of Good and Evil actions” (L 365). In the state of nature, as we have seen, individuals possess the natural right to determine what is good for themselves, i.e., what is necessary for their own conservation. As long as individuals make such determinations, Hobbes believes, there will be a state of war. In established commonwealths, religious doctrines are often responsible for civil conflict, especially in those cases where God’s law and civil law seem to be in opposition. Hobbes’s solution to the problem of conflicting religious and political powers begins by a free and unanimous consent to irrevocable place both powers under the control of the civil sovereign. Furthermore, Hobbes provides an extended interpretation of Biblical passages in part III and IV of Leviathan with the goal of showing that God’s word supports, or is consistent with, his philosophy. If the civil sovereign accepts and enforces Hobbes’s interpretation of the Holy Scriptures, it is argued, then the possibility of conflicting duties on the basis of religion will vanish. For this reason, Hobbes’s science of politics concludes that the sovereign power must be in charge of all doctrines and opinions in the commonwealth. If everyone accepts his political conclusions, Hobbes claims, then disagreement over political and religious matters would come to an end and peace would be firmly established in a commonwealth.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

References to Behemoth (B) are taken from The English Works of Thomas Hobbes of Malmesbury, ed. Sir William Molesworth, London: John Bohn, 1841, Vol. 6.

References to Leviathan (L) are taken from Leviathan, ed. C.B. Macpherson, Harmondsworth: Penguin Publishers, 1968.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Finn, S.J. (2007) Hobbes: A Guide for the Perplexed. London: Continuum Press.
  • Herbert, G. (1989), Thomas Hobbes: The Unity of Scientific and Moral Wisdom. Vancouver: University of British Columbia Press.
  • Kraynack, R. History and Modernity in the Thought of Thomas Hobbes. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Lloyd, S.A. (1992), Ideals as Interests in Hobbes’s Leviathan: The Power of Mind over Matter. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Peters, R. (1956), Hobbes. Harmondsworth: Penguin Books.
  • Sommerville, J.P. (1992), Thomas Hobbes: Political Ideas in Historical Context. London: MacMillan.
  • Sorell, T. (1986), Hobbes. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.

Author Information

Stephen Finn
Email: stephen.finn@usma.edu
United States Military Academy
U. S. A.

Adam Smith (1723—1790)

Smith_AdamAdam Smith is often identified as the father of modern capitalism. While accurate to some extent, this description is both overly simplistic and dangerously misleading. On the one hand, it is true that very few individual books have had as much impact as his An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations. His accounts of the division of labor and free trade, self-interest in exchange, the limits on government intervention, price, and the general structure of the market, all signify the moment when economics transitions to the “modern.” On the other hand, The Wealth of Nations, as it is most often called, is not a book on economics. Its subject is “political economy,” a much more expansive mixture of philosophy, political science, history, economics, anthropology, and sociology. The role of the free market and the laissez-faire structures that support it are but two components of a larger theory of human interaction and social history.

Smith was not an economist; he was a philosopher. His first book, The Theory of Moral Sentiments, sought to describe the natural principles that govern morality and the ways in which human beings come to know them. How these two books fit together is both one of the most controversial subjects in Smith scholarship and the key to understanding his arguments about the market and human activity in general. Historically, this process is made more difficult by the so-called “Adam Smith Problem,” a position put forth by small numbers of committed scholars since the late nineteenth century that Smith’s two books are incompatible. The argument suggests that Smith’s work on ethics, which supposedly assumed altruistic human motivation, contradicts his political economy, which allegedly assumed egoism. However, most contemporary Smith scholars reject this claim as well as the description of Smith’s account of human motivation it presupposes.

Smith never uses the term “capitalism;” it does not enter into widespread use until the late nineteenth century. Instead, he uses “commercial society,” a phrase that emphasizes his belief that the economic is only one component of the human condition. And while, for Smith, a nation’s economic “stage” helps define its social and political structures, he is also clear that the moral character of a people is the ultimate measure of their humanity. To investigate Smith’s work, therefore, is to ask many of the great questions that we all struggle with today, including those that emphasize the relationship of morality and economics. Smith asks why individuals should be moral. He offers models for how people should treat themselves and others. He argues that scientific method can lead to moral discovery, and he presents a blueprint for a just society that concerns itself with its least well-off members, not just those with economic success. Adam Smith’s philosophy bears little resemblance to the libertarian caricature put forth by proponents of laissez faire markets who describe humans solely as homo economicus. For Smith, the market is a mechanism of morality and social support.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Influences
    1. Early Life and Influences
    2. Smith’s Writings
  2. The Theory of Moral Sentiments
    1. Sympathy
    2. The Impartial Spectator
    3. Virtues, Duty, and Justice
  3. An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations
    1. Wealth and Trade
    2. History and Labor
    3. Political Economy
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Work by Smith
    2. Companion Volumes to the Glasgow Edition
    3. Introductions and Works for a General Audience
    4. Recommended Books for Specialists

1. Life and Influences

a. Early Life and Influences

Adam Smith was born in June, 1723, in Kirkcaldy, a port town on the eastern shore of Scotland; the exact date is unknown. His father, the Comptroller and Collector of Customs, died while Smith’s mother was pregnant but left the family with adequate resources for their financial well being. Young Adam was educated in a local parish (district) school. In 1737, at the age of thirteen he was sent to Glasgow College after which he attended Baliol College at Oxford University. His positive experiences at school in Kirkcaldy and at Glasgow, combined with his negative reaction to the professors at Oxford, would remain a strong influence on his philosophy.

In particular, Smith held his teacher Francis Hutcheson in high esteem. One of the early leaders of the philosophical movement now called the Scottish Enlightenment, Hutcheson was a proponent of moral sense theory, the position that human beings make moral judgments using their sentiments rather than their “rational” capacities. According to Hutcheson, a sense of unity among human beings allows for the possibility of other-oriented actions even though individuals are often motivated by self-interest. The moral sense, which is a form of benevolence, elicits a feeling of approval in those witnessing moral acts. Hutcheson opposed ethical egoism, the notion that individuals ought to be motivated by their own interests ultimately, even when they cooperate with others on a common project.

The term “moral sense” was first coined by Sir Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of Shaftesbury, whose work Smith read and who became a focal point in the Scots’ discussion, although he himself was not Scottish. Although Shaftesbury did not offer a formal moral sense theory as Hutcheson did, he describes personal moral deliberation as a “soliloquy,” a process of self-division and self-examination similar in form to Hamlet’s remarks on suicide. This model of moral reasoning plays an important role in Smith’s books.

The Scottish Enlightenment philosophers, or the literati, as they called themselves, were a close-knit group who socialized together and who read, critiqued, and debated each other’s work. They met regularly in social clubs (often at pubs) to discuss politics and philosophy. Shortly after graduating from Oxford, Smith presented public lectures on moral philosophy in Edinburgh, and then, with the assistance of the literati, he secured his first position as the Chair of Logic at Glasgow University. His closest friendship in the group—and probably his most important non-familial relationship throughout his life—was with David Hume, an older philosopher whose work Smith was chastised for reading while at Oxford.

Hume was believed to be an atheist, and his work brought into question some of the core beliefs in moral philosophy. In particular, and even more so than Hutcheson, Hume’s own version of moral sense theory challenged the assumption that reason was the key human faculty in moral behavior. He famously asserted that reason is and ought to be slave to the passions, which means that even if the intellect can inform individuals as to what is morally correct, agents will only act if their sentiments incline them to do so. An old proverb tells us that you can lead a horse to water but that you can’t make it drink. Hume analogously argues that while you might be able to teach people what it means to be moral, only their passions, not their rational capacities, can actually inspire them to be ethical. This position has roots in Aristotle‘s distinction between moral and intellectual virtue.

Smith, while never explicitly arguing for Hume’s position, nonetheless seems to assume much of it. And while he does not offer a strict moral sense theory, he does adopt Hume’s assertion that moral behavior is, at core, the human capacity of sympathy, the faculty that, in Hume’s account, allows us to approve of others’ characters, to “forget our own interest in our judgments,” and to consider those whom “we meet with in society and conversation” who “are not placed in the same situation, and have not the same interest with ourselves” (Hume: Treatise, book 3.3.3).

b. Smith’s Writings

Smith echoes these words throughout A Theory of Moral Sentiments. In this book, he embraces Hume’s conception of sympathy, but rejects his skepticism and adds, as we shall see, a new theory of conscience to the mix. However, focusing on Hume’s observations also allow us to see certain other themes that Smith shares with his Scottish Enlightenment cohort: in particular, their commitment to empiricism. As with most of the other Scottish philosophers, Hume and Smith held that knowledge is acquired through the senses rather than through innate ideas, continuing the legacy of John Locke more so than René Descartes. For Hume, this epistemology would bring into question the connection between cause and effect—our senses, he argued, could only tell us that certain events followed one another in time, but not that they were causally related. For Smith, this meant a whole host of different problems. He asks, for example, how a person can know another’s sentiments and motivations, as well as how members can use the market to make “rational” decisions about the propriety of their economic activity.

At the core of the Scottish project is the attempt to articulate the laws governing human behavior. Smith and his contemporary Adam Ferguson are sometimes credited with being the founders of sociology because they, along with the other literati, believed that human activities were governed by discoverable principles in the same way that Newton argued that motion was explainable through principles. Newton, in fact, was a tremendous influence on the Scots’ methodology. In an unpublished essay on the history of astronomy, Smith writes that Newton’s system, had “gained the general and complete approbation of mankind,” and that it ought to be considered “the greatest discovery that ever was made by man.” What made it so important? Smith describes it as “the discovery of an immense chain of the most important and sublime truths, all closely connected together, by one capital fact, of the reality of which we have daily experience” (EPS, Astronomy IV.76).

While Smith held the chair of logic at Glasgow University, he lectured more on rhetoric than on traditional Aristotelian forms of reasoning. There is a collection of student lecture notes that recount Smith’s discussions of style, narrative, and moral propriety in rhetorical contexts. These notes, in combination with his essay on astronomy, offer an account of explanation that Smith himself regarded as essentially Newtonian. According to Smith, a theory must first be believable; it must soothe anxiety by avoiding any gaps in its account. Again, relying upon a basically Aristotelian model, Smith tells us that the desire to learn, and the theories that result, stems from a series of emotions: surprise at events inspires anxieties that cause one to wonder about the process. This leads to understanding and admiration of the acts and principles of nature. By showing that the principles governing the heavens also govern the Earth, Newton set a new standard for explanation. A theory must direct the mind with its narrative in a way that both corresponds with experience and offers theoretical accounts that enhance understanding and allow for prediction. The account must fit together systematically without holes or missing information; this last element—avoiding any gaps in the theory—is, perhaps, the most central element for Smith, and this model of philosophical explanation unifies both his moral theories and his political economy.

As a young philosopher, Smith experimented with different topics, and there is a collection of writing fragments to compliment his lecture notes and early essays. These include brief explorations of “Ancient Logics,” metaphysics, the senses, physics, aesthetics, the work of Jean-Jacque Rousseau, and other assorted topics. Smith’s Scottish Enlightenment contemporaries shared an interest in all of these issues.

While the works offer a glimpse into Smith’s meditations, they are by no means definitive; few of them were ever authorized for publication. Smith was a meticulous writer and, in his own words, “a slow a very slow workman, who do and undo everything I write at least half a dozen of times before I can be tolerably pleased with it” (Corr. 311). As a result, he ordered sixteen volumes of unpublished writing burnt upon his death because, presumably, he did not feel they were adequate for public consumption. Smith scholars lament this loss because it obfuscates the blueprint of his system, and there have been several attempts of late to reconstruct the design of Smith’s corpus, again with the intent of arguing for a particular relationship between his major works.

After holding the chair of logic at Glasgow for only one year (1751–1752), Smith was appointed to the Chair of Moral Philosophy, the position originally held by Hutcheson. He wrote The Theory of Moral Sentiments, first published in 1759, while holding this position and, presumably, while testing out many of his discussions in the classroom. While he spoke very warmly of this period of his life, and while he took a deep interest in teaching and mentoring young minds, Smith resigned in 1764 to tutor the Duke of Buccleuch and accompany him on his travels.

It was not uncommon for professional teachers to accept positions as private tutors. The salary and pensions were often lucrative, and it allowed more flexibility than a busy lecturing schedule might afford. In Smith’s case, this position took him to France where he spent two years engaged with the philosophes—a tight-knit group of French philosophers analogous to Smith’s own literati—in conversations that would make their way into The Wealth of Nations. How influential the philosophes were in the creation of Smith’s political economy is a matter of controversy. Some scholars suggest that Smith’s attitudes were formed as a result of their persuasion while others suggest that Smith’s ideas were solidified much earlier than his trip abroad. Whatever the case, this shows that Smith’s interests were aligned, not just with the Scottish philosophers, but with their European counterparts. Smith’s writing was well-received in part because it was so timely. He was asking the deep questions of the time; his answers would change the world.

After his travels, Smith returned to his home town of Kirkcaldy to complete The Wealth of Nations. It was first published in 1776 and was praised both by his friends and the general public. In a letter written much later, he referred to it as the “very violent attack I had made upon the whole commercial system of Great Britain” (Corr. 208). The Theory of Moral Sentiments went through six editions in Smith’s lifetime, two of which contained major substantive changes and The Wealth of Nations saw four different editions with more minor alterations. Smith indicated that he thought The Theory of Moral Sentiments was a better book, and his on-going attention to its details and adjustments to its theory bear out, at least, that he was more committed to refining it. Eventually, Smith moved to Edinburgh with his mother and was appointed commissioner of customs in 1778; he did not publish anything substantive for the remainder of his life. Adam Smith died on July 17, 1790.

After his death, The Wealth of Nations continued to grow in stature and The Theory of Moral Sentiments began to fade into the background. In the more than two centuries since his death, his published work has been supplemented by the discoveries of his early writing fragments, the student-authored lectures notes on his course in rhetoric and belles-letters, student-authored lecture notes on jurisprudence, and an early draft of part of The Wealth of Nations, the date of which is estimated to be about 1763. The latter two discoveries help shed light on the formulation of his most famous work and supply fodder for both sides of the debate regarding the influence of the philosophes on Smith’s political economy.

As stated above, Smith is sometimes credited with being one of the progenitors of modern sociology, and his lectures on rhetoric have also been called the blueprint for the invention of the modern discipline of English; this largely has to do with their influence on his student Hugh Blair, whose own lectures on rhetoric were instrumental in the formation of that discipline. The Theory of Moral Sentiments played an important role in 19th century sentimentalist literature and was also cited by Mary Wollstonecraft to bolster her argument in A Vindication of the Rights of Women: Smith’s moral theories experienced a revival in the last quarter of the twentieth century. Secondary sources on Smith flooded the marketplace and interest in Smith’s work as a whole has reached an entirely new audience.

There are two noteworthy characteristics of the latest wave of interest in Smith. The first is that scholars are interested in how The Theory of Moral Sentiments and The Wealth of Nations interconnect, not simply in his moral and economic theories as distinct from one another. The second is that it is philosophers and not economists who are primarily interested in Smith’s writings. They therefore pay special attention to where Smith might fit in within the already established philosophical canon: How does Smith’s work build on Hume’s? How does it relate to that of his contemporary Immanuel Kant? (It is known that Kant read The Theory of Moral Sentiments, for example.) To what extent is a sentiment-based moral theory defensible? And, what can one learn about the Scots and eighteenth-century philosophy in general from reading Smith in a historical context? These are but a few of the questions with which Smith’s readers now concern themselves.

2. The Theory of Moral Sentiments

a. Sympathy

Hutcheson, Hume, and Smith were unified by their opposition to arguments put forth by Bernard Mandeville. A Dutch-born philosopher who relocated to England, Mandeville argued that benevolence does no social good whatsoever. His book, The Fable of the Bees: Private Vices, Public Benefits, tells the whole story. Bad behavior has positive social impact. Without vice, we would have, for example, no police, locksmiths, or other such professionals. Without indulgence, there would be only minimal consumer spending. Virtue, on the other hand, he argued, has no positive economic benefit and is therefore not to be encouraged.

But Mandeville took this a step further, arguing, as did Thomas Hobbes, that moral virtue derives from personal benefit, that humans are essentially selfish, and that all people are in competition with one another. Hobbes was a moral relativist, arguing that “good” is just a synonym for “that which people desire.” Mandeville’s relativism, if it can be called that, is less extreme. While he argues that virtue is the intentional act for the good of others with the objective of achieving that good, he casts doubt on whether or not anyone could actually achieve this standard. Smith seems to treat both philosophers as if they argue for the same conclusion; both offer counterpoints to Shaftesbury’s approach. Tellingly, Mandeville writes wistfully of Shaftesbury’s positive accounts of human motivation, remarking they are “a high Compliment to Human-kind,” adding, however, “what Pity it is that they are not true” (Fable, I, 324).

Smith was so opposed to Hobbes’s and Mandeville’s positions that the very first sentence of The Theory of Moral Sentiments begins with their rejection:

However selfish man may be supposed, there are evidently some principles in his nature, which interest him in the fortune of others, and render their happiness necessary to him, though they derive nothing from it except the pleasure of seeing it. (TMS I.i.1.1)

While it is often assumed that people are selfish, Smith argues that experience suggests otherwise. People derive pleasure from seeing the happiness of others because, by design, others concern us. With this initial comment, Smith outlines the central themes of his moral philosophy: human beings are social, we care about others and their circumstances bring us pleasure or pain. It is only through our senses, through “seeing,” that we acquire knowledge of their sentiments. Smith’s first sentence associates egoism with supposition or presumption, but scientific “principles” of human activity are associated with evidence: Newtonianism and empiricism in action.

The Theory of Moral Sentiments (TMS) is a beautifully written book, clear and engaging. With few exceptions, the sentences are easy to follow, and it is written in a lively manner that speaks of its rehearsal in the classroom. Smith has a particular flair for examples, both literary and from day-to-day life, and his use of “we” throughout brings the reader into direct dialogue with Smith. The book feels like an accurate description of human emotions and experience—there are times when it feels phenomenological, although Smith would not have understood this word. He uses repetition to great benefit, reminding his readers of the central points in his theories while he slowly builds their complexity. At only 342 pages (all references are to the Glasgow Editions of his work), the book encompasses a tremendous range of themes. Disguised as a work of moral psychology—as a theory of moral sentiments alone—it is also a book about social organization, identity construction, normative standards, and the science of human behavior as a whole.

Smith tells us that the two questions of moral philosophy are “Wherein does virtue consist?” and “By what power or faculty in the mind is it, that this character, whatever it be, is recommended to us?” (TMS VII.i.2) In other words, we are to ask what goodness is and how we are to be good. The Theory of Moral Sentiments follows this plan, although Smith tackles the second question first, focusing on moral psychology long before he addresses the normative question of moral standards. For Smith, the core of moral learning and deliberation—the key to the development of identity itself—is social unity, and social unity is enabled through sympathy.

The term “sympathy” is Hume’s, but Smith’s friend gives little indication as to how it was supposed to work or as to its limits. In contrast, Smith addresses the problem head on, devoting the first sixty-six pages of TMS to illuminating its workings and most of the next two hundred elaborating on its nuances. The last part of the book (part VII, “Of Systems of Moral Philosophy”) is the most distanced from this topic, addressing the history of ethics but, again, only for slightly less than sixty pages. It is noteworthy that while modern writers almost always place the “literature review” in the beginning of their books, Smith feels that a historical discussion of ethics is only possible after the work on moral psychology is complete. This is likely because Smith wanted to establish the principles of human behavior first so that he could evaluate moral theory in the light of what had been posited.

The Theory of Moral Sentiments is, not surprisingly, both Aristotelian and Newtonian. It is also Stoic in its account of nature and self-command. The first sentence quoted above is a first principle—individuals are not egoistic—and all the rest of the book follows from this assertion. And, as with all first principles, while Smith “assumes” the possibility of other-oriented behavior, the rest of the book both derives from its truth and contributes to its believability. Smith’s examples, anecdotes, and hypotheticals are all quite believable, and if one is to accept these as accurate depictions of the human experience, then one must also accept his starting point. Human beings care for others, and altruism, or beneficence as he calls it, is possible.

What is sympathy, then? This is a matter of controversy. Scholars have regarded it as a faculty, a power, a process, and a feeling. What it is not, however, is a moral sense in the most literal meaning of the term. Sympathy is not a sixth capacity that can be grouped with the five senses. Smith, while influenced by Hutcheson, is openly critical of his teacher. He argues that moral sense without judgment is impossible (TMS VII.3.3.8-9), and sympathy is that which allows us to make judgments about ourselves and others. Sympathy is the foundation for moral deliberation, Smith argues, and Hutcheson’s system has no room for it.

For Smith, sympathy is more akin to modern empathy, the ability to relate to someone else’s emotions because we have experienced similar feelings. While contemporary “sympathy” refers only to feeling bad for a person’s suffering, Smith uses it to denote “fellow-feeling with any passion whatever” (TMS I.i.1.5). It is how a “spectator… changes places in fancy with… the person principally concerned” (TMS I.i.1.3-5).

In short, sympathy works as follows: individuals witness the actions and reactions of others. When doing so, this spectator attempts to enter into the situation he or she observes and imagines what it is like to be the actor—the person being watched. (Smith uses actor and agent interchangeably.) Then, the spectator imagines what he or she would do as the actor. If the sentiments match up, if the imagined reaction is analogous to the observed reaction, then the spectator sympathizes with the original person. If the reactions are significantly different, then the spectator does not sympathize with the person. In this context, then, sympathy is a form of moral approval and lack of sympathy indicates disapproval.

Sympathy is rarely exact. Smith is explicit that the imagined sentiments are always less intense than the original, but they are nonetheless close enough to signify agreement. And, most important, mutual sympathy is pleasurable. By nature’s design, people want to share fellow-feeling with one another and will therefore temper their actions so as to find common ground. This is further indication of the social nature of human beings; for Smith, isolation and moral disagreement is to be avoided. It is also the mechanism that moderates behavior. Behavior modulation is how individuals learn to act with moral propriety and within social norms. According to The Theory of Moral Sentiments, mutual sympathy is the foundation for reward and punishment.

Smith is insistent, though, that sympathy is not inspired by simply witnessing the emotions of others even though it “may seem to be transfused from one man to another, instantaneously, and antecedent to any knowledge of what excited them in the person principally concerned” (TMS I.i.1.6). Rather, the spectator gathers information about the cause of the emotions and about the person being watched. Only then does he or she ask, given the particular situation and the facts of this particular agent’s life, whether the sentiments are appropriate. As Smith writes:

When I condole with you for the loss of your only son, in order to enter into your grief I do not consider what I, a person of such a character and profession, should suffer, if I had a son, and if that son was unfortunately to die: but I consider what I should suffer if I was really you, and I not only change circumstance with you, but I change persons and characters. My grief, therefore, is entirely upon your own account, and not in the least upon my own. (TMS VI.iii.I.4)

We can see here why the imagination is so important to Smith. Only through this faculty can a person enter into the perspective of another, and only through careful observation and consideration can someone learn all the necessary information relevant to judge moral action. We can also see why sympathy is, for Smith, not an egoistic faculty:

In order to produce this concord, as nature teaches the spectators to assume the circumstances of the person principally concerned, so she teaches this last in some measure to assume those of the spectators. As they are continually placing themselves in his situation, and thence conceiving emotions similar to what he feels; so he is as constantly placing himself in theirs, and thence conceiving some degree of that coolness about his own fortune, with which he is sensible that they will view it. As they are constantly considering what they themselves would feel, if they actually were the sufferers, so he is as constantly led to imagine in what manner he would be affected if he was only one of the spectators of his own situation. As their sympathy makes them look at it, in some measure, with his eyes, so his sympathy makes him look at it, in some measure, with theirs, especially when in their presence and acting under their observation: and as the reflected passion, which he thus conceives, is much weaker than the original one, it necessarily abates the violence of what he felt before he came into their presence, before he began to recollect in what manner they would be affected by it, and to view his situation in this candid and impartial light. (TMS I.i.4.8)

Contrary to the description put forth by the Adam Smith Problem, sympathy cannot be either altruistic or egoistic because the agents are too intertwined. One is constantly making the leap from one point of view to another, and happiness and pleasure are dependant on joint perspectives. Individuals are only moral, and they only find their own happiness, from a shared standpoint. Egoism and altruism melt together for Smith to become a more nuanced and more social type of motivation that incorporates both self-interest and concern for others at the same time.

Typical of Smith, the lengthy paragraph cited above leads to at least two further qualifications. The first is that, as Smith puts it, “we expect less sympathy from a common acquaintance than from a friend… we expect still less sympathy from an assembly of strangers” (TMS I.1.4.10). Because sympathy requires information about events and people, the more distance we have from those around us, the more difficult it is for us to sympathize with their more passionate emotions (and vice versa). Thus, Smith argues, we are to be “more tranquil” in front of acquaintances and strangers; it is unseemly to be openly emotional around those who don’t know us. This will lead, eventually, to Smith’s discussion of duty in part III—his account of why we act morally towards those with whom we have no connection whatsoever.

The second qualification is more complex and revolves around the last phrase in the paragraph: that one must observe actions in a “candid and impartial light.” If movement toward social norms were the only component to sympathy, Smith’s theory would be a recipe for homogeneity alone. All sentiments would be modulated to an identical pitch and society would thereafter condemn only difference. Smith recognizes, therefore, that there must be instances in which individuals reject community judgment. They do so via the creation of an imagined impartial spectator.

b. The Impartial Spectator

Using the imagination, individuals who wish to judge their own actions create not just analogous emotions but an entire imaginary person who acts as observer and judge:

When I endeavour to examine my own conduct, when I endeavour to pass sentence upon it, and either to approve or condemn it, it is evident that, in all such cases, I divide myself, as it were, into two persons; and that I, the examiner and judge, represent a different character from that other I, the person whose conduct is examined into and judged of. The first is the spectator, whose sentiments with regard to my own conduct I endeavour to enter into, by placing myself in his situation, and by considering how it would appear to me, when seen from that particular point of view. The second is the agent, the person whom I properly call myself, and of whose conduct, under the character of a spectator, I was endeavouring to form some opinion. The first is the judge; the second the person judged of. But that the judge should, in every respect, be the same with the person judged of, is as impossible, as that the cause should, in every respect, be the same with the effect. (TMS III.1.6)

The impartial spectator is the anthropomorphization of the calm and disinterested self that can be recovered with self control and self reflection. In today’s world, someone might advise us to “take a deep breath and step back” from a given situation in order to reflect on our actions more dispassionately. Smith is suggesting the same, although he is describing it in more detail and in conjunction with the larger ethical theory that helps us find conclusions once we do so. Individuals who wish to judge their own actions imaginatively split themselves into two different people and use this bifurcation as a substitute for community observation.

Here we see the legacy of Shaftesbury’s soliloquy. An actor who wishes to gauge his or her own behavior has to divide him or herself in the way that Shaftesbury describes, in the way that Hamlet becomes both poet and philosopher. We are passionate about our own actions, and self-deception, according to Smith, is “the source of half the disorders of human life” (TMS III.4.6). Self-division gives individuals the ability to see themselves candidly and impartially and leads us to better self-knowledge. We strive to see ourselves the way others see us, but we do so while retaining access to the privileged personal information that others might not have. The community helps us see past our own biases, but when the community is limited by its own institutionalized bias or simply by lack of information, the impartial spectator can override this and allow an agent to find propriety in the face of a deformed moral system. In the contemporary world, racism and sexism are examples of insidious biases that prevent the community from “seeing” pain and injustice. Smith too can be read as recognizing these prejudices, although he would not have recognized either the terms or the complicated discourses about them that have evolved since he wrote two and a half centuries ago. For example, he cites slavery as an instance of the injustice and ignorance of a community. He writes:

There is not a Negro from the coast of Africa who does not, in this respect, possess a degree of magnanimity which the soul of his sordid master is too often scarce capable of conceiving. Fortune never exerted more cruelly her empire over mankind, than when she subjected those nations of heroes to the refuse of the jails of Europe, to wretches who possess the virtues neither of the countries which they come from, nor of those which they go to, and whose levity, brutality, and baseness, so justly expose them to the contempt of the vanquished. (TMS V.2.9)

Despite its corrective potential, impartiality has its limits. Smith does not imagine the impartial spectator to see from an Archimedean or God’s eye point of view. Because the impartial spectator does not really exist—because it is created by an individual person’s imagination—it is always subject to the limits of a person’s knowledge. This means that judgment will always be imperfect and those moral mistakes that are so profoundly interwoven into society or a person’s experience are the hardest to overcome. Change is slow and society is far from perfect. “Custom,” as he calls it, interferes with social judgment on both the collective and the individual level. There are two points, according to Smith, when we judge our own actions, before and after we act. As he writes, “Our views are apt to be very partial in both cases; but they are apt to be most partial when it is of most importance that they should be otherwise” (TMS 111.4.2). Neither of these points is independent of social influence.

Knowledge is imperfect and individuals do the best they can. But all individuals are limited both by their own experiences and the natural inadequacies of the human mind. Smith’s suggestion, then, is to have faith in the unfolding of nature, and in the principles that govern human activity—moral, social, economic, or otherwise. With this in mind, however, he cautions people against choosing the beauty of systems over the interest of people. Abstract philosophies and abstruse religions are not to take precedent over the evidence provided by experience, Smith argues. Additionally, social engineering is doomed to fail. Smith argues that one cannot move people around the way one moves pieces on a chess board. Each person has his or her “own principle of motion… different from that which the legislature might choose to impress upon” them (TMS VI.ii.2.18).

Smith’s caution against the love of systems is a component of Smith’s argument for limited government: “Harmony of minds,” Smith argues, is not possible without “free communication of settlements and opinion,” or, as we would call it today, freedom of expression (TMS VII.iv.27). It also offers a direct connection to Smith’s most famous phrase “the invisible hand.” In The Theory of Moral Sentiments, he uses the invisible hand to describe the conditions that allow for economic justice. This natural aesthetic love of systems leads people to manipulate the system of commerce, but this interferes with nature’s plan:

The rich only select from the heap what is most precious and agreeable. They consume little more than the poor, and in spite of their natural selfishness and rapacity, though they mean only their own conveniency, though the sole end which they propose from the labours of all the thousands whom they employ, be the gratification of their own vain and insatiable desires, they divide with the poor the produce of all their improvements. They are led by an invisible hand to make nearly the same distribution of the necessaries of life, which would have been made, had the earth been divided into equal portions among all its inhabitants, and thus without intending it, without knowing it, advance the interest of the society, and afford means to the multiplication of the species. (TMS IV.1.10)

In this passage, Smith argues that “the capacity of [the rich person’s] stomach bars no proportion to the immensity of his desires, and will receive no more than that of the meanest peasant” (TMS IV.1.10). Thus, because the rich only select “the best” and because they can only consume so much, there ought to be enough resources for everyone in the world, as if an invisible hand has divided the earth equally amongst all its inhabitants.

As an economic argument, this might have been more convincing in Smith’s time, before refrigeration, the industrial revolution, modern banking practices, and mass accumulation of capital; for a more thorough defense (from Smith’s point of view) see the discussion of The Wealth of Nations. However, its relevance to the history of economics is based upon his recognition of the role of unintended consequences, the presumption that economic growth helps all members of the society, and the recognition of the independence of the free market as a natural force. At present, we can focus on Smith’s warnings about the power of aesthetic attraction. The Newtonian approach, Smith argues—the search for a coherent narrative without gaps that addresses surprise, wonder, and admiration—can lead people astray if they prioritize beauty over the evidence. This love of the beautiful can also deform moral judgments because it causes the masses to over-value the rich, to think the wealthy are happy with their “baubles and trinkets,” and thus to pursue extreme wealth at the cost of moral goodness: “To attain to this envied situation, the candidates for fortune too frequently abandon the paths of virtue; for unhappily, the road which leads to the one and that which leads to the other, lie sometimes in very opposite directions” (TMS I.iii.8). Smith is very critical not only of the rich, but of the moral value society places on them. Only their wealth makes them different, and this love of wealth, and of beauty in general, can distort moral judgment and deform the impartial spectator.

The impartial spectator is a theory of conscience. It provides individuals with the opportunity to assent to their own standards of judgment, which, hopefully, are in general agreement with the standards of the society that houses them. Difference, as Smith discusses in both of his books, is the product of education, economic class, gender, what we would now call ethnic background, individual experience, and natural abilities; but Smith argues that the last of these, natural abilities, constitute the least of the factors. In his Lectures on Jurisprudence, for example, he argues that there is no “original difference” between individuals (LJ(A) vi.47-48), and in The Wealth of Nations, he writes that “The difference of natural talents in different men is, in reality, much less than we are aware of…. The difference between the most dissimilar characters, between a philosopher and a street porter, for example, seems to arise not so much from nature, as from habit, custom and education” (WN I.ii.4). Society and education, hopefully, help to bridge these gaps, and help to cultivate a unified community where people are encouraged to sympathize with others.

Here is the overlap in Smith’s two operative questions. First, one encounters his account of moral psychology. (How does one come to know virtue?) Now one comes face to face with the identification of moral standards themselves. (Of what does virtue consist?) Smith may look like a relativist at times: individuals modulate their sentiments to their community standards, and agreement of individual imaginations may falsely seem to be the final arbiter of what is morally appropriate behavior. With this in mind, there are certainly readers who will argue that Smith, despite his rejection of Hobbes and Mandeville, ends up offering no universally binding moral principles. This, however, forgets Smith’s Newtonian approach: observation leads to the discovery of natural principles that can be repeatedly tested and verified. Furthermore, many scholars argue that Smith was strongly influenced by the classical Stoics. In addition to inheriting their concern with the modulation of emotions and the repression of emotions in public, he also likely thought that moral laws are written into nature’s design in just the same way that Newton’s laws of motion are. As a result, some Smith scholars (but certainly not all) argue that Smith is a moral realist, that sympathy is a method of discovery rather than invention, and that what is to be discovered is correct independent of the opinions of those who either know or are ignorant of the rules.

Consistent with this interpretation, Smith emphasizes what he terms the general rules of morality:

…they are ultimately founded upon experience of what, in particular instances, our moral faculties, our natural sense of merit and propriety, approve, or disapprove of. We do not originally approve or condemn particular actions; because, upon examination, they appear to be agreeable or inconsistent with a certain general rule. The general rule, on the contrary, is formed, by finding from experience, that all actions of a certain kind, or circumstanced in a certain manner, are approved or disapproved of. To the man who first saw an inhuman murder, committed from avarice, envy, or unjust resentment, and upon one too that loved and trusted the murderer, who beheld the last agonies of the dying person, who heard him, with his expiring breath, complain more of the perfidy and ingratitude of his false friend, than of the violence which had been done to him, there could be no occasion, in order to conceive how horrible such an action was, that he should reflect, that one of the most sacred rules of conduct was what prohibited the taking away the life of an innocent person, that this was a plain violation of that rule, and consequently a very blamable action. His detestation of this crime, it is evident, would arise instantaneously and antecedent to his having formed to himself any such general rule. The general rule, on the contrary, which he might afterwards form, would be founded upon the detestation which he felt necessarily arise in his own breast, at the thought of this, and every other particular action of the same kind. (TMS III.4.8)

According to Smith, our sentiments give rise to approval or condemnation of a moral act. These can be modified over time with additional information. Eventually, though, spectators, see patterns in the condemnation. They see, for example, that murder is always wrong, and therefore derive a sense that this is a general rule. They begin, then, to act on the principle rather than on the sentiment. They do not murder, not simply because they detest murder, but because murder is wrong in itself. This, again, is Aristotelian in that it recognizes the interaction between intellectual and moral virtue. It also shares commonalities with the Kantian deontology that became so influential several decades after the publication of TMS. Like Kant, Smith’s agents begin to act on principle rather than emotion. Unlike Kant, however, reason in itself does not justify or validate the principle, experience does.

Smith does several things in the last excerpt. First, he embraces the Newtonian process of scientific experimentation and explanation. Moral rules are akin to the laws of physics; they can be discovered. Second, Smith anticipates Karl Popper’s twentieth-century claim that scientific truths are established through a process of falsification: we cannot prove what is true, Popper argued. Instead, we discover what is false and rule it out.

c. Virtues, Duty, and Justice

Smith emphasizes a number of virtues along with duty and justice. Self-command, he argues “is not only itself a great virtue, but from it all the other virtues seem to derive their principle lustre” (TMS VI.iii.11). This should not be surprising since, for Smith, it is only through self-command that agents can modulate their sentiments to the pitch required either by the community or the impartial spectator. Self-command is necessary because “the disposition to anger, hatred, envy, malice, [and] revenge… drive men from one another,” while “humanity, kindness, natural affection, friendship, [and] esteem… tend to unite men in society” (TMS VI.iii.15). One can see, then, the normative content of Smith’s virtues—those sentiments that are to be cultivated and those that are to be minimized. According to Smith, humans have a natural love for society and can develop neither moral nor aesthetic standards in isolation.

Individuals have a natural desire not only be to be loved, but to be worthy of love: “He desires not only praise, but praiseworthiness,… he dreads not only blame, but blame-worthiness” (TMS III.2.2). This speaks first to the power of the impartial spectator who is a guide to worth when no spectators are around. It also speaks to Smith’s conception of duty, in that it sets a standard of right action independent of what communities set forth. Individuals “derive no satisfaction” from unworthy praise (TMS III.2.5), and doing so is an indication of the perversion of vanity than can be corrected by seeing ourselves the way others would, if they knew the whole story.

It should not be surprising that Smith addresses God amidst his discussion of duty:

The all-wise Author of Nature has, in this manner, taught man to respect the sentiments and judgments of his brethren; to be more or less pleased when they approve of his conduct, and to be more or less hurt when they disapprove of it. He has made man, if I may say so, the immediate judge of mankind; and has, in this respect, as in many others, created him after his own image, and appointed him his vicegerent upon earth, to superintend the behaviour of his brethren. They are taught by nature, to acknowledge that power and jurisdiction which has thus been conferred upon him, to be more or less humbled and mortified when they have incurred his censure, and to be more or less elated when they have obtained his applause. (TMS III.2.31)

Here Smith makes several points. First, like many of the Scots, as well as Thomas Jefferson and many of the American founders, Smith was a deist. While there is controversy amongst scholars about the extent to which God is necessary to Smith’s theory, it is likely that he believed that God designed the universe and its rules, and then stepped back as it unfolded. Smith’s God is not an interventionist God and, despite some readers suggesting the contrary, the invisible hand is not an indication of God’s involvement in creation. It is, instead, just the unfolding of sociological and economic principles. Second, because God is detached from the system, Smith argues that human beings are God’s regents on earth. It is up to them to be the judges of their own behavior. Individuals are necessarily most concerned with themselves first, and are therefore best self-governed. Only then can they judge others via the moral system Smith describes. While it is true that, as Smith puts it, the general rules are “justly regarded as the laws of the deity” (TMS III.v), this seems to be a point of motivation, not of metaphysical assertion. If individuals understand the general rules as stemming from God, then they will follow them with more certainty and conviction. “The terrors of religion should thus enforce the natural sense of duty” (TMS III.5.7), Smith writes, because it inspires people to follow the general rules even if they are inclined not to do so, and because this support makes religion compatible with social and political life. Religious fanaticism, as Smith points out in The Wealth of Nations, is one of the great causes of factionalism—the great enemy of political society.

For Smith, the most precise virtue is justice. It is “the main pillar that upholds the whole edifice” of society (TMS III.ii.4). It is, as he describes it, “a negative virtue” and the minimal condition for participation in the community. Obeying the rules of justice, therefore, result in little praise, but breaking them inspires great condemnation:

There is, no doubt, a propriety in the practice of justice, and it merits, upon that account, all the approbation which is due to propriety. But as it does no real positive good, it is entitled to very little gratitude. Mere justice is, upon most occasions, but a negative virtue, and only hinders us from hurting our neighbour. The man who barely abstains from violating either the person, or the estate, or the reputation of his neighbours, has surely very little positive merit. He fulfils, however, all the rules of what is peculiarly called justice, and does every thing which his equals can with propriety force him to do, or which they can punish him for not doing. We may often fulfil all the rules of justice by sitting still and doing nothing. (TMS II.ii.1.9)

Smith’s account of justice assumes that individual rights and safety are core concerns. He writes:

The most sacred laws of justice, therefore, those whose violation seems to call loudest for vengeance and punishment, are the laws which guard the life and person of our neighbour; the next are those which guard his property and possessions; and last of all come those which guard what are called his personal rights, or what is due to him from the promises of others. (TMS II.ii.2.3)

His discussion of justice is supplemented in The Wealth of Nations and would have likely been added to in his proposed work on “the general principles of law and government” that he never completed. His lectures on jurisprudence give one a hint as to what might have been in that work, but one must assume that the manuscript was part of the collection of works burnt upon his death. (It is not even known what was actually destroyed, let alone what the works argued.) It is frustrating for Smith’s readers to have such gaps in his theory, and Smith scholars have debated the possible content of his other work and the way it relates to his first book. It is clear, though, that The Theory of Moral Sentiments is only one part of Smith’s larger system, and one truly understands it only in light of his other writing. It is therefore necessary to switch the discussion from his work on moral philosophy to his political economy. As will be evident, this break is not a radical one. The two books are entirely compatible with one another and reading one supplements reading the other; both contain moral claims and both make assertions classified as political economy. While their emphases are different much of the time—they are two different books after all—their basic points are more than just harmonious. They depend upon one another for justification.

3. An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations

a. Wealth and Trade

The Wealth of Nations (WN) was published in March of 1776, four months before the signing of the American Declaration of Independence. It is a much larger book than The Theory of Moral Sentiments—not counting appendices and indices, it runs 947 pages. To the first time reader, therefore, it may seem more daunting than Smith’s earlier work, but in many ways, it is actually a simpler read. As he grew older, Smith’s writing style became more efficient and less flowery, but his authorial voice remained conversational. His terms are more strictly defined in WN than in TMS, and he clearly identifies those positions he supports and rejects. His economic discussions are not as layered as his comments on morality, so the interpretive issues are often less complex. The logic of the book is transparent: its organizational scheme is self-explanatory, and its conclusions are meticulously supported with both philosophical argument and economic data. There are many who challenge its assertions, of course, but it is hard to deny that Smith’s positions in WN are defensible even if, in the end, some may conclude that he is wrong.

The text is divided into five “books” published in one, two, or three bound volumes depending on the edition. The first books outline the importance of the division of labor and of self-interest. The second discusses the role of stock and capital. The third provides an historical account of the rise of wealth from primitive times up until commercial society. The fourth discusses the economic growth that derives from the interaction between urban and rural sectors of a commercial society. The fifth and final book presents the role of the sovereign in a market economy, emphasizing the nature and limits of governmental powers and the means by which political institutions are to be paid for. Smith, along with his Scottish Enlightenment contemporaries, juxtaposes different time periods in order to find normative guidance. As TMS does, The Wealth of Nations contains a philosophy of history that trusts nature to reveal its logic and purpose.

This is a remarkable scope, even for a book of its size. Smith’s achievement, however, is not simply the multitude of his discussions, but how he makes it all fit together. His most impressive accomplishment in The Wealth of Nations is the presentation of a system of political economy. Smith makes seemingly disparate elements interdependent and consistent. He manages to take his Newtonian approach and create a narrative of both power and beauty, addressing the philosophical along with the economic, describing human behavior and history, and prescribing the best action for economic and political betterment. And, he does so building on a first principle that was at least as controversial as the sentence that began The Theory of Moral Sentiments. He begins the introduction by asserting:

The annual labour of every nation is the fund which originally supplies it with all the necessaries and conveniencies of life which it annually consumes, and which consist always either in the immediate produce of that labour, or in what is purchased with that produce from other nations. (WN intro.1)

The dominant economic theory of Smith’s time was mercantilism. It held that the wealth of a nation was to be assessed by the amount of money and goods within its borders at any given time. Smith calls this “stock.” Mercantilists sought to restrict trade because this increased the assets within the borders which, in turn, were thought to increase wealth. Smith opposed this, and the sentence cited above shifted the definition of national wealth to a different standard: labor.

The main point of The Wealth of Nations is to offer an alternative to mercantilism. Labor brings wealth, Smith argues. The more one labors the more one earns. This supplies individuals and the community with their necessities, and, with enough money, it offers the means to make life more convenient and sometimes to pursue additional revenue. Free trade, Smith argues, rather than diminishing the wealth of the nation, increases it because it provides more occasion for labor and therefore more occasion to create more wealth. Limited trade keeps the amount of wealth within the borders relatively constant, but the more trade a country engages in, the wider the market becomes and the more potential there is for additional labor and, in turn, additional wealth. This point leads Smith to divide stock into two parts, that which is used for immediate consumption—the assets that allow a person to acquire necessities—and that which is used to earn additional revenue. This latter sum he calls “capital” (WN II.1.2), and the term “capitalism” (which, again, Smith does not use) is derived from its use in a commercial system: capital is specifically earmarked for reinvestment and is therefore a major economic engine.

This is, of course, a philosophical point as much as an economic one: Smith asks his readers to reconsider the meaning of wealth itself. Is wealth the money and assets that one has at any given time, or is it these things combined with the potential to have more, to adjust to circumstances, and to cultivate the skills to increase such potential? Smith thinks it is the latter. Smith is also concerned specifically with the distinction between necessities and conveniences. His overarching concern in The Wealth of Nations is the creation of “universal opulence which extends itself to the lowest ranks of the people” (WN I.i.10). In other words, Smith believes that a commercial system betters the lives for the worst off in society; all individuals should have the necessities needed to live reasonably well. He is less concerned with “conveniences” and “luxuries;” he does not argue for an economically egalitarian system. Instead, he argues for a commercial system that increases both the general wealth and the particular wealth of the poorest members. He writes:

Is this improvement in the circumstances of the lower ranks of the people to be regarded as an advantage or as an inconveniency to the society? The answer seems at first sight abundantly plain. Servants, labourers and workmen of different kinds, make up the far greater part of every great political society. But what improves the circumstances of the greater part can never be regarded as an inconveniency to the whole. No society can surely be flourishing and happy, of which the far greater part of the members are poor and miserable. It is but equity, besides, that they who feed, cloath and lodge the whole body of the people, should have such a share of the produce of their own labour as to be themselves tolerably well fed, cloathed and lodged. (WN I.viii.36)

Smith argues that the key to the betterment of the masses is an increase in labor, productivity, and workforce. There are two main factors that influence this: “the skill, dexterity, and judgment with which its labour is generally applied,” and “the proportion between the number of those who are employed in useful labour, and that of those who are not” (WN intro.3).

Smith repeats the phrase “skill, dexterity and judgment” in the first paragraph of the body of the book, using it to segue into a discussion of manufacture. Famously, he uses the division of labor to illustrate the efficiency of workers working on complementary specific and narrow tasks. Considering the pin-maker, he suggests that a person who was required to make pins by him or herself could hardly make one pin per day, but if the process were divided into a different task for different people—”one man draws out the wire, another straights it, a third cuts it, a fourth points it, a fifth grinds it at the top for receiving the head; to make the head requires two or three distinct operations; to put it on, is a peculiar business, to whiten the pins is another”—then the factory could make approximately forty-eight thousand pins per day (WN I.i.3).

The increase in efficiency is also an increase in skill and dexterity, and brings with it a clarion call for the importance of specialization in the market. The more focused a worker is on a particular task the more likely they are to create innovation. He offers the following example:

In the first fire-engines, a boy was constantly employed to open and shut alternately the communication between the boiler and the cylinder, according as the piston either ascended or descended. One of those boys, who loved to play with his companions, observed that, by tying a string from the handle of the valve which opened this communication, to another part of the machine, the valve would open and shut without his assistance, and leave him at liberty to divert himself with his play-fellows. One of the greatest improvements that has been made upon this machine, since it was first invented, was in this manner the discovery of a boy who wanted to save his own labour. (WN I.i.8)

This example of a boy looking to ease his work day, illustrates two separate points. The first is the discussion at hand, the importance of specialization. In a commercial society, Smith argues, narrow employment becomes the norm: “Each individual becomes more expert in his own peculiar branch, more work is done upon the whole, and the quantity of science is considerably increased by it” (WN I.i.9). However, the more important point—certainly the more revolutionary one—is the role of self-interest in economic life. A free market harnesses personal desires for the betterment not of individuals but of the community.

Echoing but tempering Mandeville’s claim about private vices becoming public benefits, Smith illustrates that personal needs are complementary and not mutually exclusive. Human beings, by nature, have a “propensity to truck, barter, and exchange one thing for another” (WN I.ii.1). This tendency, which Smith suggests may be one of the “original principles in human nature,” is common to all people and drives commercial society forward. In an oft-cited comment, Smith observes,

It is not from the benevolence of the butcher, the brewer, or the baker, that we expect our dinner, but from their regard to their own self-interest. We address ourselves, not to their humanity but to their self-love, and never talk to them of our own necessities but of their advantages. (WN I.ii.2)

Philosophically, this is a tectonic shift in moral prescription. Dominant Christian beliefs had assumed that any self-interested action was sinful and shameful; the ideal person was entirely focused on the needs of others. Smith’s commercial society assumes something different. It accepts that the person who focuses on his or her own needs actually contributes to the public good and that, as a result, such self-interest should be cultivated.

Smith is not a proponent of what would today be called rampant consumerism. He is critical of the rich in both of his books. Instead, his argument is one that modern advocates of globalization and free trade will find familiar: when individuals purchase a product, they help more people than they attempted to do so through charity. He writes:

Observe the accommodation of the most common artificer or day-labourer in a civilized and thriving country, and you will perceive that the number of people of whose industry a part, though but a small part, has been employed in procuring him this accommodation, exceeds all computation. The woollen coat, for example, which covers the day-labourer, as coarse and rough as it may appear, is the produce of the joint labour of a great multitude of workmen. The shepherd, the sorter of the wool, the wool-comber or carder, the dyer, the scribbler, the spinner, the weaver, the fuller, the dresser, with many others, must all join their different arts in order to complete even this homely production. How many merchants and carriers, besides, must have been employed in transporting the materials from some of those workmen to others who often live in a very distant part of the country! how much commerce and navigation in particular, how many ship-builders, sailors, sail-makers, rope-makers, must have been employed in order to bring together the different drugs made use of by the dyer, which often come from the remotest corners of the world! What a variety of labour too is necessary in order to produce the tools of the meanest of those workmen! To say nothing of such complicated machines as the ship of the sailor, the mill of the fuller, or even the loom of the weaver, let us consider only what a variety of labour is requisite in order to form that very simple machine, the shears with which the shepherd clips the wool. The miner, the builder of the furnace for smelting the ore, the feller of the timber, the burner of the charcoal to be made use of in the smelting-house, the brick-maker, the brick-layer, the workmen who attend the furnace, the mill-wright, the forger, the smith, must all of them join their different arts in order to produce them. Were we to examine, in the same manner, all the different parts of his dress and household furniture, the coarse linen shirt which he wears next his skin, the shoes which cover his feet, the bed which he lies on, and all the different parts which compose it, the kitchen-grate at which he prepares his victuals, the coals which he makes use of for that purpose, dug from the bowels of the earth, and brought to him perhaps by a long sea and a long land carriage, all the other utensils of his kitchen, all the furniture of his table, the knives and forks, the earthen or pewter plates upon which he serves up and divides his victuals, the different hands employed in preparing his bread and his beer, the glass window which lets in the heat and the light, and keeps out the wind and the rain, with all the knowledge and art requisite for preparing that beautiful and happy invention, without which these northern parts of the world could scarce have afforded a very comfortable habitation, together with the tools of all the different workmen employed in producing those different conveniencies; if we examine, I say, all these things, and consider what a variety of labour is employed about each of them, we shall be sensible that without the assistance and co-operation of many thousands, the very meanest person in a civilized country could not be provided, even according to what we very falsely imagine, the easy and simple manner in which he is commonly accommodated. Compared, indeed, with the more extravagant luxury of the great, his accommodation must no doubt appear extremely simple and easy; and yet it may be true, perhaps, that the accommodation of an European prince does not always so much exceed that of an industrious and frugal peasant, as the accommodation of the latter exceeds that of many an African king, the absolute master of the lives and liberties of ten thousand naked savages. (WN I.i.11)

The length of this excerpt is part of its argumentative power. Smith is not suggesting, simply, that a single purchase benefits a group of people. Instead, he is arguing that once you take seriously the multitude of people whose income is connected to the purchase of the single coat, it is hard to even grasp the numbers we are considering. A single purchase brings with it a vast network of laborers. Furthermore, he argues, while one may be critical of the inevitable class difference of a commercial society, the differential is almost inconsequential compared to the disparity between the “haves” and “have-nots” in a feudal or even the most primitive societies. (Smith’s reference to “a thousand naked savages” is just thoughtless eighteenth century racism and can be chalked-up to the rhetoric of the time. It ought to be disregarded and has no impact on the argument itself.) It is the effect of one minor purchase on the community of economic agents that allows Smith to claim, as he does in TMS, that the goods of the world are divided equally as if by an invisible hand. For Smith, the wealthy can purchase nothing without benefiting the poor.

According to The Wealth of Nations, the power of the woolen coat is the power of the market at work, and its reach extends to national economic policy as well as personal economic behavior. Smith’s comments relate to his condemnation of social engineering in The Theory of Moral Sentiments, and he uses the same metaphor—the invisible hand—to condemn those mercantilists who think that by manipulating the market, they can improve the lot of individual groups of people.

But the annual revenue of every society is always precisely equal to the exchangeable value of the whole annual produce of its industry, or rather is precisely the same thing with that exchangeable value. As every individual, therefore, endeavours as much as he can both to employ his capital in the support of domestic industry, and so to direct that industry that its produce may be of the greatest value; every individual necessarily labours to render the annual revenue of the society as great as he can. He generally, indeed, neither intends to promote the public interest, nor knows how much he is promoting it. By preferring the support of domestic to that of foreign industry, he intends only his own security; and by directing that industry in such a manner as its produce may be of the greatest value, he intends only his own gain, and he is in this, as in many other cases, led by an invisible hand to promote an end which was no part of his intention. Nor is it always the worse for the society that it was no part of it. By pursuing his own interest he frequently promotes that of the society more effectually than when he really intends to promote it. I have never known much good done by those who affected to trade for the public good. It is an affectation, indeed, not very common among merchants, and very few words need be employed in dissuading them from it. (WN IV.2.9)

Smith begins his comments here with a restatement of the main point of The Wealth of Nations: “…the annual revenue of every society is always precisely equal to the exchangeable value of the whole annual produce of its industry, or rather is precisely the same thing with that exchangeable value.” The income of any community is its labor. Smith’s remarks about the invisible hand suggest that one can do more damage by trying to manipulate the system than by trusting it to work. This is the moral power of unintended consequences, as TMS’s account of the invisible hand makes clear as well.

What Smith relies upon here is not “moral luck” as Bernard Williams will later call it, but, rather, that nature is logical because it operates on principles, and, therefore, certain outcomes can be predicted. Smith recognizes that human beings and their interactions are part of nature and not to be understood separately from it. As in The Theory of Moral Sentiments, social and political behavior follows a natural logic. Now Smith makes the same claim for economic acts. Human society is as natural as the people in it, and, as such, Smith rejects the notion of a social contract in both of his books. There was never a time that humanity lived outside of society, and political development is the product of evolution (not his term) rather than a radical shift in organization. The state of nature is society for Smith and the Scots, and, therefore, the rules that govern the system necessitate certain outcomes.

b. History and Labor

Smith’s account of history describes human civilization as moving through four different stages, time periods that contain nations of hunters, nations of shepherds, agricultural nations, and, finally commercial societies (WN V.i.a, see, also, LJ(A) i.27; see also LJ(B) 25, 27, 149, 233). This is progress, Smith insists, and each form of society is superior to the previous one. It is also natural. This is how the system is designed to operate; history has a logic to it. Obviously, this account, in fact all of The Wealth of Nations, was very influential for Karl Marx. It marks the important beginning of what would be called social science—Smith’s successor to the Chair of Moral Philosophy, Adam Ferguson, is often identified as the founder of modern sociology—and is representative of the project the Scottish Enlightenment thinkers referred to as “the science of man.”

Smith’s discussion of history illustrates two other important points. First, he argues that the primary economic tension, and, as a result, the primary economic engine, in any given society can be found in the interaction between “the inhabitants of the town and those of the country” (WN III.i.1). According to Smith, agricultural lands supply the means of sustenance for any given society and urban populations provide the means of manufacture. Urban areas refine and advance the means of production and return some of its produce to rural people. In each of the stages, the town and country have a different relationship with each other, but they always interact.

Here, Smith is indebted to the physiocrats, French economists who believed that agricultural labor was the primary measure of national wealth. Smith accepted their notion that productive labor was a component of the wealth of nations but rejected their notion that only agricultural labor should be counted as value. He argues, instead, that if one group had to be regarded as more important, it would be the country since it provides food for the masses, but that it would be a mistake to regard one’s gain as the other’s loss or that their relationship is essentially hierarchical: “the gains of both are mutual and reciprocal, and the division of labour is in this, as in all other cases, advantageous to all the different persons employed in the various occupations into which it is subdivided” (WN III.i.1).

Again, there are philosophical issues here. First, is what one is to regard as labor; second is what counts towards economic value. Additionally, Smith is showing how the division of labor works on a large scale; it is not just for pin factories. Rather, different populations can be dedicated to different tasks for everyone’s benefit. (This might be an anticipation of David Ricardo’s notion of “comparative advantage.”) A commercial system is an integrated one and the invisible hand ensures that what benefits one group can also benefit another. Again, the butcher, brewer, and baker gain their livelihood by manufacturing the lunch of their customers.

Returning to Smith’s account of history, Smith also argues that historical moments and their economic arrangements help determine the form of government. As the economic stage changes, so does the form of government. Economics and politics are intertwined, Smith observes, and a feudal system could not have a republican government as is found in commercial societies. What Smith does here, again, is anticipate Marx’s dialectical materialism, showing how history influences economic and political options, but, of course, he does not take it nearly as far as the German does close to a century later.

Given the diversity of human experience—WN‘s stage theory of history helps account for difference—Smith is motivated to seek unifying standards that can help translate economic value between circumstances. Two examples are his discussions of price and his paradox of value. Within these discussions, Smith seeks an adequate measure of “worth” for goods and services. Consumers look at prices to gauge value, but there are good and bad amounts; which is which is not always transparent. Some items are marked too expensive for their actual value and some are a bargain. In developing a system to account for this interaction, Smith offers a range of different types of prices, but the two most important are natural price—the price that covers all the necessary costs of manufacture—and the market price, what a commodity actually goes for on the market. When the market and the natural prices are identical, the market is functioning well: “the natural price, therefore, is, as it were, the central price to which the prices of all commodities are continually gravitating” (WN I.vii.15).

Here, the term “gravitating” indicates, yet again, that there are principles that guide the economic system, and a properly functioning marketplace—one in which individuals are in “perfect liberty”—will have the natural and market prices coincide (WN i.vii.30). (Smith defines perfect liberty as a condition under which a person “may change his trade as often as he pleases” (WN I.vii.6)). Whether this is a normative value, whether for Smith the natural price is better than other prices, and whether the market price of a commodity should be in alignment with the natural price, is a matter of debate.

Following the question of worth, Smith poses the paradox of value. He explains: “Nothing is more useful than water: but it will purchase scarce any thing; scarce anything can be had in exchange for it. A diamond, on the contrary, has scarce any value in use; but a very great quantity of other goods may frequently be had in exchange for it” (WN I.iv.13). Smith’s question is straightforward: why is water so much cheaper than diamonds when it is so much more important for everyday life?

Obviously, we are tempted to argue that scarcity plays a role in the solution to this paradox; water is more valuable than diamonds to a person dying of thirst. For Smith, however, value, here, is general utility and it seems problematic to Smith that the more useful commodity has the lower market price. His solution, then, is to distinguish between two types of value, “value in use” and “value in exchange”—the former is the commodity’s utility and the latter is what it can be exchanged for in the market. Dividing the two analytically allows consumers to evaluate the goods both in terms of scarcity and in terms of usefulness. However, Smith is also searching for a normative or objective core in a fluctuating and contextual system, as with the role of impartiality in his moral system. Scarcity would not solve this problem because that, too, is fluctuating; usefulness is largely subjective and depends on an individual’s priorities and circumstance. Smith seeks a more universal criterion and looks towards labor to anchor his notion of value: “labour,” he writes, “is the real measure of the exchangeable value of all commodities” (WN I.v).

What Smith means by this is unclear and a matter of controversy. What seems likely, though, is that one person’s labor in any given society is not significantly different from another person’s. Human capabilities do not change radically from one time period or location to another, and their labor, therefore, can be compared: “the difference of natural talents in different men is, in reality, much less than we are aware of.” He elaborates:

Labour, therefore, it appears evidently, is the only universal, as well as the only accurate measure of value, or the only standard by which we can compare the values of different commodities at all times and at all places. We cannot estimate, it is allowed, the real value of different commodities from century to century by the quantities of silver which were given for them. We cannot estimate it from year to year by the quantities of corn. By the quantities of labour we can, with the greatest accuracy, estimate it both from century to century and from year to year. From century to century, corn is a better measure than silver, because, from century to century, equal quantities of corn will command the same quantity of labour more nearly than equal quantities of silver. From year to year, on the contrary, silver is a better measure than corn, because equal quantities of it will more nearly command the same quantity of labour. (WN I.v.17)

In other words, for example, a lone person can only lift so much wheat at one go, and while some people are stronger than others, the differences between them don’t make that much difference. Therefore, Smith seems to believe, the value of any object can be universally measured by the amount of labor that any person in any society might have to exert in order to acquire that object. While this is not necessarily a satisfying standard to all—many economists argue that the labor theory of value has been surpassed—it does, again, root Smith’s objectivity in impartiality. The “any person” quality of the impartial spectator is analogous to the “any laborer” standard Smith seems to use as a value measure.

Ultimately, according to Smith, a properly functioning market is one in which all these conditions—price, value, progress, efficiency, specialization, and universal opulence (wealth)—all work together to provide economic agents with a means to exchange accurately and freely as their self-interest motivates them. None of these conditions can be met if the government does not act appropriately, or if it oversteps its justified boundaries.

c. Political Economy

The Wealth of Nations is a work of political economy. It is concerned with much more than the mechanisms of exchange. It is also concerned with the ideal form of government for commercial advancement and the pursuit of self-interest. This is where Smith’s reputation as a laissez faire theorist comes in. He is arguing for a system, as he calls it, of “natural liberty,” one in which the market largely governs itself as is free from excessive state intervention (recall Smith’s use of the invisible hand in TMS). As he explains, there are only three proper roles for the sovereign: to protect a society from invasion by outside forces, to enforce justice and protect citizens from one another, and “thirdly, the duty of erecting and maintaining certain publick works and certain publick institutions, which it can never be for the interest of any individual, or small number of individuals, to erect and maintain; because the profit could never repay the expence to any individual or small number of individuals, though it may frequently do much more than repay it to a great society” (WN IV.ix).

Each of the responsibilities of the sovereign contains its own controversies. Regarding the first, protecting society, Smith debated with others as to whether a citizen militia or a standing army was better suited for the job, rooting his discussion, as usual, in a detailed history of the military in different stages of society (WN V.1.a). Given the nature of specialization, it should not be surprising that Smith favored the army (WN V.1.a.28). The nature of justice—the second role of the sovereign—is also complicated, and Smith never fully articulated his theory of what justice is and how it ought to be maintained, although, as we have seen, he was liberal in his assumptions of the rights of individuals against the imposition of government on matters of conscience and debate. In his chapter on “the expence of justice” (WN V.i.b), he discusses the nature of human subordination and why human beings like to impose themselves on one another. However, it is the third role of the sovereign—the maintenance of works that are too expensive for individuals to erect and maintain, or what are called “natural monopolies”—that is the most controversial.

It is this last book—ostensibly about the expenditures of government—that shows most clearly what Smith had in mind politically; the government plays a much stronger role in society than is often asserted. In particular, book five addresses the importance of universal education and social unity. Smith calls for religious tolerance and social regulation against extremism. For Smith, religion is an exceptionally fractious force in society because individuals tend to regard theological leaders as having more authority than political ones. This leads to fragmentation and social discord.

The discussion of “public goods” includes an elaborate discussion of toll roads, which, on the face of it, may seem to be a boring topic, but actually includes a fascinating account of why tolls should be based on the value of transported goods rather than on weight. This is Smith’s attempt to protect the poor—expensive goods are usually lighter than cheaper goods—think of diamonds compared to water—and if weight were the standard for tolls, justified, perhaps, by the wear and tear that the heavier goods cause, the poor would carry an undue share of transportation costs (WN V.i.d). However, the most intriguing sections of Book Five contain his two discussions of education (WN V.i.f–V.i.g). The first articulates the role of education for youth and the second describes the role of education for “people of all ages.”

The government has no small interest in maintaining schools to teach basic knowledge and skills to young people. While some of the expense is born by parents, much of this is to be paid for by society as a whole (WN V.i.f.54-55). The government also has a duty to educate adults, both to help counter superstition and to remedy the effects of the division of labor. Regarding the first, an educated population is more resistant to the claims of extremist religions. Smith also advocates public scrutiny of religious assertions in an attempt to moderate their practices. This, of course, echoes Smith’s moral theory in which the impartial spectator moderates the more extreme sentiments of moral agents. Finally, Smith insists that those who govern abandon associations with religious sects so that their loyalties do not conflict.

Regarding the second purpose of education for all ages, and again, anticipating Marx, Smith recognizes that the division of labor is destructive towards an individual’s intellect. Without education, “the torpor” (inactivity) of the worker’s mind:

renders him, not only incapable of relishing or bearing a part in any rational conversation, but of conceiving any generous, noble, or tender sentiment, and consequently of forming any just judgment concerning many even of the ordinary duties of private life. Of the great and extensive interests of his country, he is altogether incapable of judging; and unless very particular pains have been taken to render him otherwise, he is equally incapable of defending his country in war…. His dexterity at his own particular trade seems, in this manner, to be acquired at the expence of his intellectual, social, and martial virtues. But in every improved and civilized society this is the state into which the labouring poor, that is, the great body of the people, must necessarily fall, unless government takes some pains to prevent it. (WN V.i.f.50)

Education helps individuals overcome the monotony of day to day life. It helps them be better citizens, better soldiers, and more moral people; the intellect and the imagination are essential to moral judgment. No person can accurately sympathize if his or her mind is vacant and unskilled.

We see here that Smith is concerned about the poor throughout The Wealth of Nations. We also see the connections between his moral theory and his political economy. It is impossible to truly understand why Smith makes the political claims he does without connecting them to his moral claims, and vice versa. His call for universal wealth or opulence and his justification of limited government are themselves moral arguments as much as they are economic ones. This is why the Adam Smith Problem doesn’t make sense and why contemporary Smith scholars are so focused on showing the systematic elements of Smith’s philosophy. Without seeing how each of the parts fit together, one loses the power behind his reasoning—reasoning that inspired as much change as any other work in the history of the Western tradition. Of course, Smith has his detractors and his critics. He is making claims and building on assumptions that many challenge. But Smith has his defenders too, and, as history bears out, Smith is still an important voice in the investigation of how society ought to be organized and what principles govern human behavior, inquiry, and morality. The late twentieth century revival in Smith’s studies underscores that Smith’s philosophy may be as important now as it ever was.

4. References and Further Reading

All references are to The Glasgow Edition of the Correspondence and Works of Adam Smith, the definitive edition of his works. Online versions of much of these can be found at The Library of Economics and Liberty.

a. Work by Smith

  • [TMS] Theory of Moral Sentiments. Ed. A.L. Macfie and D.D. Raphael. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
    • First published in 1759; subsequent editions in 1761 (significantly revised), 1767, 1774, 1781, and 1790 (significantly revised with entirely new section).
  • [WN] An Inquiry into the Nature and Causes of the Wealth of Nations. 2 vols. Ed. R.H. Campbell and A.S. Skinner. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1976.
    • First published in 1776; subsequent editions in 1778, 1784 (significantly revised), 1786, 1789.
  • [LJ] Lectures on Jurisprudence. Ed. R.L. Meek and D.D. Raphael. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
    • Contains two sets of lectures, LJ(A), dated 1762–3 and LJ(B) dated 1766.
  • [LRBL] The Lectures on Rhetoric and Belles Lettres. Ed. J.C. Bryce. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1985.
    • Edition also contains the fragment: “Considerations Concerning the First Formation of Languages” in LRBL. Lecture dates, 1762–1763.
  • [EPS] Essays on Philosophical Subjects. Ed. W.P.D. Wightman and J.C. Bryce. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1982.
    • Contains the essays and fragments: “The Principles Which Lead and Direct Philosophical Enquires Illustrated by the History of Astronomy,” “The Principles Which Lead and Direct Philosophical Enquires Illustrated by the History of Ancient Physics,” “ThePrinciples which lead and direct Philosophical Enquiries Illustrated by the History of the Ancient Logics and Metaphysics,”Of the External Senses,“Of the Nature of that Imitation which takes place in what are called The Imitative Arts,” “Of the Affinity between Music, Dancing, and Poetry,” “Of the Affinity between certain English and Italian Verses,” Contributions to the Edinburgh Review of 1755-56, Review of Johnson’s Dictionary, A Letter to the Authors of the Edinburgh Review, Preface and Dedication to William Hamilton’s Poems on Several Occasions 261 and Dugald Stewart’s “Account of the Life and Writings of Adam Smith, LL.D.” First published in 1795.
  • [Corr.] Correspondence of Adam Smith. Ed. E.C. Mossner and I.S. Ross. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 1987.

b. Companion Volumes to the Glasgow Edition

  • Index to the Works of Adam Smith. Ed K. Haakonssen and A.S. Skinner. Indianapolis,: Liberty Press, 2002.
  • Essays on Adam Smith. Edited by A.S. Skinner and Thomas Wilson. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1976.
  • Life of Adam Smith. I.S. Ross. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.

c. Introductions and Works for a General Audience

  • Berry, Christopher J. The Social Theory of the Scottish Enlightenment. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1997.
  • Fleischacker, Samuel. On Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
  • Haakonssen, K. (ed.) The Cambridge Companion to Adam Smith. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
  • Muller, Jerry Z. Adam Smith in His Time and Ours. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1993.
  • Otteson, James R. Adam Smith: Selected Philosophical Writings (Library of Scottish Philosophy). Exeter: Imprint Academic, 2004.
  • Weinstein, Jack Russell. On Adam Smith. Belmont: Wadsworth, 2001.
  • Raphael, D.D. Adam Smith (Past Masters). Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.

d. Recommended Books for Specialists

Any issue of the journal The Adam Smith Review will be of interest to Smith’s readers. Volume 2 (2007) has a special symposium on Smith’s notion of rational choice (economic deliberation), and Volume 3 (2008) will have a special symposium on Smith and education. Both may deserve special attention.

  • Campbell, T.D. Adam Smith’s Science of Morals. New Jersey: Rowman and Littlefield, 1971.
  • Cropsey, Joseph. Polity and Economy: An Interpretation of the Principles of Adam Smith (With Further Thoughts on the Principles of Adam Smith) (Revised Edition). Chicago: St. Augustine’s Press, 2001.
  • Evensky, J. Adam Smith’s Moral Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
  • Force, Pierre. Self-interest before Adam Smith. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
  • Griswold, Charles L. Jr. Adam Smith and the Virtues of Enlightenment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
  • Haakonssen, Knud (ed.). Adam Smith (The International Library of Critical Essays in the History of Philosophy. Aldershot: Ashgate/Dartmouth Publishing, 1998.
  • Haakonssen, Knud. The Science of A Legislator. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.
  • Montes, Leonidas. Adam Smith in Context. New York: Palgrave MacMillan, 2004.
  • Otteson, James. Adam Smith’s Marketplace of Life. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
  • Raphael, D.D. The Impartial Spectator. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007.
  • Scott, William Robert. Adam Smith as Student and Professor. New York: Augusts M. Kelley, 1965.
  • Teichgraeber, Richard. Free Trade and Moral Philosophy: Rethinking the Sources of Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations. Durham, Duke University Press, 1986.
  • Weinstein, Jack Russell. Adam Smith’s Pluralism: Rationality Education and the Moral Sentiments. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013.

Author Information

Jack Russell Weinstein
Email: jack.weinstein@und.edu
University of North Dakota
U. S. A.

René Descartes: Scientific Method

painting of DescartesRené Descartes’ major work on scientific method was the Discourse that was published in 1637 (more fully: Discourse on the Method for Rightly Directing One’s Reason and Searching for Truth in the Sciences). He published other works that deal with problems of method, but this remains central in any understanding of the Cartesian method of science. The common picture of Descartes is as one who proposed that all science become demonstrative in the way Euclid made geometry demonstrative, namely as a series of valid deductions from self-evident truths, rather than as something rooted in observation and experiment. Descartes is usually portrayed as one who defends and uses an a priori method to discover infallible knowledge, a method rooted in a doctrine of innate ideas that yields an intellectual knowledge of the essences of the things with which we are acquainted in our sensible experience of the world. This metaphysics of essences and the accompanying a priori method are then contrasted to the method of Newton, Bacon and the British empiricists, who denied the metaphysics of essences and the doctrine of innate ideas, and for whom knowledge of the world of sensible appearances was to be located, not by going outside it to a realm of essences, but by applying the method of experiment through which one could trace out the patterns in this world of causes and effects. There is something to this standard picture, but Descartes’ thought, like that of the empiricists, goes far beyond this simple description. In fact, Descartes sought to found our knowledge of things as much in experience and in experiment as in things a priori.

Table of Contents

  1. Science as Observation and Experiment
    1. Laws about Laws
    2. Models of “How Possibly”
    3. Application to Human Physiology
  2. Cartesian Rationalism
    1. A Priori Method
    2. Geometrical Deduction
    3. Deduction in the Discourse and Meditations
  3. Method of Doubt
  4. Conclusion
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Bibliographical Study
    3. Secondary Sources

1. Science as Observation and Experiment

a. Laws about Laws

Let us begin in the middle of one of these essays, the Optics, and in particular its Fifth Discourse, “Of Vision.” There Descartes asks the reader to turn to experience, observational knowledge. He asks the reader to carefully observe an eyeball, say that of an ox, from which a portion of the rear has been removed with sufficient care to leave the eyeball fluid untouched. The portion removed is covered with a thin piece of paper. Descartes then describes how one can view the image formed on the back of the eyeball of objects at varying distances from the front of the eyeball, how the size of the image varies with distance, becomes fuzzier when the eyeball is squeezed, and so on. These were observations that had not before been recorded: they were part of the “new world” that science was just beginning to explore. The method was to, in the first place, explore it by empirical observation. Look, but look carefully and systematically.

To observe, however, is not to explain, and the new science seeks also to explain. Descartes has prepared the way for this. In earlier Discourses in the Optics, he presented the laws of geometrical optics for reflection and refraction. The former was already well known, but the sine law for refraction was newly discovered. (Huygens was later to complain that Descartes had not referred to Snell, who is now generally credited with the discovery of this law.) Descartes carefully shows how the lens of the eyeball, in conformity with the law of refraction, focuses light arriving from the object to form the image on the retina. The more particular biological facts of sight can be explained by the more general laws of geometrical optics.

The sine law of refraction is the general form of a set of laws: the angle of refraction will depend upon the particular transparent substances through which the light passes. The actual angle for any pair of substances will have to be determined by experiment.

Notice the structure of these inferences. There is a general law to the effect that for any situation of certain generic sort, there are specific laws that have some generic form. This is a law about laws. This law about laws serves as an abstract generic theory, and it yields, in regard to any specific sort of situation falling under the genus, the conclusion that, for such a specific sort of situation, there is a law (this has been called a “Principle of Determinism”) and that this law will have a certain generic form and not any other sort of form (this has been called a “Principle of Limited Variety”). These two Principles provide a framework within which the scientist searching after truth works as he or she attempts to locate the law of the relevant generic sort that is there, according to theory, to be discovered. There will be a number of specific possibilities, each of the relevant generic sort. The task will be to turn to experiment to eliminateall possibilities but one by finding counterexamples. The un-eliminated hypothesis will be the specific law one is aiming to discover. In particular, such experiments will determine the constant of refraction that the sine law asserts to be there for specific pairs of transparent substances. Experiment will confirm the un-eliminated specific hypothesis, and this will in turn confirm the more generic theory that predicted the existence of a law of that relevant form.

The direction of the light rays as they pass from one substance to another will be determined not just by the constant of refraction, but also by the curvature of the surface that is the interface boundary. Descartes shows how the shape of a lens contributes to the formation of images. This again is a generic description of the laws applying to many specific situations. Descartes applies this knowledge to account for the various effects that can be produced on the image on the retina, for example, by squeezing the eyeball to distort the lens of the eye in various ways.

In later Discourses in the Optics Descartes goes on to show how this knowledge of patterns or regularities among things and events of the sensible world can be used to design telescopes, recently used effectively by Galileo, and to design lenses that can be used to remedy defects in eyesight. Descartes is using the knowledge of patterns not only to explain things newly noticed in observation, but also to apply it in ways useful to the further scientific exploration of the world (telescopes) and to make ordinary life better (corrective lenses).

The laws about laws that are the laws of reflection and refraction are themselves laws of physics, laws of matter in motion. In his presentation of these laws in the earlier Discourses in the Optics, Descartes uses a speculative model of light as consisting of little particles akin to tennis balls, only much smaller. This kinship is not only one of shape but one of the generic form of the laws that describe the motions of these two sorts of entity. He assumes that the particles of light move in straight lines. In the case of reflection he assumes that the light, that is, these light particles, strike an impenetrable surface and bounce off. In the case of the refraction he assumes the particles pass from a medium of one density to and through one with another density. The deductions Descartes offers are, in particular in the case of refraction, of questionable validity, but that is not to the present point; our interest is in the Cartesian method or methods and not how he actually applies them.

Descartes is clearly open to speculation because the model he uses for light is one that lacked empirical confirmation. He offered little evidence for his model of light. But it has two uses. One is as a heuristic device, to be used to discover laws, such as that of refraction, which can themselves be confirmed in experience. The experimental confirmation of these specific laws will also confirm the laws of the generic theory that has been discovered by means of the heuristic model.

He was clear, in his own mind at least, that the model had hardly be given a demonstration in the sense in which one could give in geometry the sort of demonstration given by Euclid. He wrote to Mersenne:

You ask me whether I think what I have written about refraction is a demonstration. I think it is, at least as far as it is possible, without having proved the principles of physics previously by metaphysics, to give any demonstration in this subject … as far as any other question of mechanics, optics, or astronomy, or any other question which is not purely geometrical or arithmetical, has ever been demonstrated. But to demand that I should give geometrical demonstrations of matters which depend on physics is to demand that I should do the impossible. If you restrict the use of “demonstration” to geometrical proofs only, you will be obliged to say that Archimedes demonstrated nothing in mechanics, nor Vitello in optics, nor Ptolemy in astronomy, etc., which is not commonly maintained. For, in such matters, one is satisfied that the writers, having presupposed certain things which are not obviously contradictory to experience, have besides argued, consistently and without logical fallacy, even if their assumptions are not exactly true. (27 May 1638)

b. Models of “How Possibly”

The other use which these models have is to yield what might be called “how possibly” explanations. Many explained that sight occurred by immaterial sensory species, images of the objects being observed, being given off by those objects, and impinging upon the eye. The challenge was more or less that something like this must be so because no purely material explanation, in terms of particles interacting mechanically, could be given for the person becoming aware of the form of the object viewed. Descartes’ model showed how this could be so because it explained how it possibly could be that there is a mechanical process that accounts for the facts of sight without invoking immaterial entities.

Descartes works out further this “how possibly” model, when he goes on in the Optics to elaborate a vision of the biological workings of a complete physiology that, like the more restricted case of the workings of the eyeball, can be explained by the supposed laws of a mechanistic physics. He lays out the idea that there certain fluids – “animal spirits” – carrying in effect messages from the sense organs to the brain, and to the pineal gland in particular – where he supposes the messages to be read as it were by the mind – this is the point of contact between the mind as a mental substance and the body as a, or more accurately as a part of the, material substance. The pineal gland is where the science of physics and material things stops, and the metaphysics of mind takes over. We need not pursue the line of the perceptual process from body into mind.

These “how possibly” uses of mechanistic models clearly introduce a research program, both of discovering the specific laws they suggest are there and confirming that the models do represent the structure of the world.

There was another point to the development of these “how possibly” models. The Roman physician Galen had written a work On the Usefulness of Bodily Parts, which thoroughly examined anatomical and physiological functioning. It was based on dissection, mainly of animals, and some experiment, and a good deal of speculation. Overall, it argued the thesis not only that the parts of the body are useful to the survival and good life of the animal or human being, but more strongly that the existence of these parts was to be explained by their utility–they existed in virtue of the fact that they contributed to the Good. While connected to the past, the cause of their existence was the form of the Good, their final cause, drawing them from the future into the present. Galen’s work was openly teleological, a perspective developed by Plato, first in the Phaedo against Anaxagoras, and extended by Aristotle, against the mechanism of Democritus and Epicurus and Lucretius. While rejecting the anti-theological positions adopted by these latter Greek and Roman philosophers, Descartes sided with them in opposing teleological explanations. To be sure, anatomy and physiological processes did contribute to the survival and well being of animals and human beings, but their explanation was entirely in terms of mechanistic causes. Descartes’ “how possibly” explanations aim to establish that our understanding of bodily processes needs no teleology because research can proceed here much as it proceeds in physics. That is, the science of human physiology is the same in kind as the science of stones.

c. Application to Human Physiology

Descartes was prepared to extend his guess to the whole set of natural processes defining the human being (save for rational thought and action under control of the conscious will). In the early 1630s he composed a Treatise on Man (Traité de l’homme), which he suppressed on learning of Galileo’s condemnation in 1633. It appeared only posthumously, in 1664, when it was published along with another unfinished work, this one from 1647/8, The Description of the Human Body (La Description du Corps Humaine). The latter is sometimes titled “On the Formation of the Fetus,” though this is misleading as this is only part, albeit an important part, of what the work covers. The Treatise begins deliberately with the supposition that God has built a statue which is a “machine made from earth,” with a heart, a brain, and so on, but a contrivance which in detail works much like a clock, only in more complicated ways. The complex mechanisms are assumed to be able to approximate those of a human, but as it is imagined as a machine we will not be tempted to attribute its motions to the various mysterious powers, vegetative and sensitive souls, and so on, as did Aristotle and the Scholastics. Descartes’ program aimed to show that all but rational and deliberately willed and self-conscious behavior could, in principle, at least, be explained as material processes operating according to mechanistic laws. He therefore elaborates “how possibly” such a machine might work. He describes how a “man of earth” analogous to clocks and to the automata, powered by water and doing various things, constructed by engineers for the gardens of the rich, but incredibly more complex, might be constructed by God and how it might work. The mechanisms envisioned by Descartes for this “man machine” in the Treatise are quite complex, although in comparison to what we now know of these mechanisms, they are simplistic and crude. The Description is a more curious work, dealing with the development of the human being from sperm through fetus to grown adult person. It consists mainly of assertions and coarse sketches of the mechanisms supposed to be involved. It was still a “how possibly” explanation, but it certainly was less persuasive than other parts of Descartes’ sketches of a non-Galenic, non-Aristotelian mechanistic vision of the human body.

Once Descartes’ program in anatomy and physiology became known, its impact was immense: it was a breath of fresh air that swept away old ideas that merely obfuscated things, and opened up a “new world” for scientific investigation. Still, there were those who were not convinced. The English philosopher, Henry More, was one of these. He argued that the complexity of the human body and activity, indeed the complexity of plants and animals, could not be accounted for in terms of the bouncings and collisions of billiard balls of different sizes. He corresponded with Descartes on these issues, and his ideas appeared in a book On the Immortality of the Soul (1659; included together with Letters to Descartes in hisPhilosophical Writings, 1662). More argued that the bodies of living things, including humans, had an irreducible complexity that mere mechanisms could not account for, and that non-material entities and forces, “plastic forms,” were needed. Needless to say, these plastic forms were non-empirical entities. The idea is with us still, with those who deny the inadequacy of natural selection to explain the origin of complex biological mechanisms. No doubt Descartes had not shown “how possibly” the physicalist mechanisms would work. This was especially true of the Cartesian account of the development of the fetus: the passage of information from the sperm to the developing organs begged for the idea of an immaterial Form or final cause pulling the matter together into a whole unlike in any way its genetic antecedents. More thought this way. He could not envision a more complicated physics, one that included the molecular biology of DNA molecules materially embodying the required information. A physics much more developed than Descartes and More could conceive, certainly much more than the levers and billiard balls and flowing fluids that formed the limits of their vision. But while, in the end, physics went well beyond that limited Cartesian concept of the laws of physics to the laws of quantum mechanics and of molecular biology, these are still the laws of physics and it is still physics which forms the basic patterns of causation in physiology. Thus, it has been the Cartesian vision of a world that is to be understood physically, and the Cartesian method that has triumphed, and it is no longer “how possibly” it works, but rather how it actually works.

Descartes laid out the basic framework for empirical investigation in the main body of the Discourse on Method, in the Fifth Part. He makes specific reference to William Harvey’s experiments that established the circulation of the blood, against the views of Galen, drawing attention to the eliminative role of observations in determining which, among several possible cases, is the one which is true. He indicates the need for a background generic theory to guide research by providing a principle of determinism and a principle of limited variety. Descartes is well aware of the logical structure of the research process for investigating the natural world, and discovering the laws of that world.

The background theory that is needed is the thesis that the world operates through mechanical processes and mechanisms that obey the laws of physics. Discoveries such as that of Harvey confirm these generic laws that guide the research. But there is more to it than that. This is where Descartes slips from the idea of science as empirical to the idea of science as a priori, from the idea of science as a method rooted in observation and experiment to the idea of a science whose method is rooted in the demonstrations of pure reason.

2. Cartesian Rationalism

a. A Priori Method

Descartes argues that the laws in the basic mechanistic framework that he takes to hold for sciences like optics and physiology – these laws about laws that guide empirical research in these sciences – are not themselves empirical but are rather necessary truths that are knowable a priori. Thus far we have seen that Descartes is well aware of the logical structure of the experimental method in natural science. To that extent he is not a philosopher who asserts that the a priori method applies everywhere. But he is nonetheless correctly to be counted among the rationalists. In fact he argues that in principle at least all laws could be known a priori. It is just that the world of ordinary things is too complicated in its structure for us, with our finite minds and limited capacity to grasp the a priori structure of the world, to deduce from self-evident premises the laws of the mechanisms underlying ordinary observable things and processes. We can know a priori the law about laws that there are more specific laws with the generic structure of physical mechanisms, of machines. But what those specific laws are requires empirical research; they are too complex logically to be knowable a priori by us, with our finite capacities.

Descartes argues that all things, including the material world we know by sense, have an inner essence or form, and its presence explains the structure of things as they ordinarily appear. These essences or forms are known not by sense but by reason. Reason is precisely the capacity to grasp these essences which are the reasons for things, the reasons why there are these patterns and regularities in the sensible world rather than others. He takes for granted that when the form is known that form is literally in the mind of the knower: there is an identity of the knower and the known. To grasp the essence of a thing is to know a priori the structure and behavior of the thing of which it is the essence. Material things are all modes of a single substance, the essence of which is extension. When we grasp the axioms of geometry as necessary truths, we are grasping the logical and ontological structure of the material world. Descartes is like Aristotle in attributing essences to things, but for Aristotle knowledge of the essence is given by syllogisms and by real definitions of species in terms of genus and specific difference. For Descartes, the structure is given by the truths of geometry.

Descartes holds in the Fifth Part of the Discourse on Method that the basic laws of physics are those of the geometry of objects in motion. These laws, he suggests, can be deduced from our knowledge of God. He creates a world the essence of which is given by the laws of geometry together with the principle that in any change quantity of motion is conserved. This conservation principle is thought to follow from the unchanging nature and stability of God the creator. There is a much more detailed derivation in thePrinciples of Philosophy. It is far from adequate. Descartes’ knowledge of the laws of physics and of mechanics falls far short of Newton’s. Perhaps this shows the weakness of the a priori method proposed by Descartes for obtaining the basic framework laws for science, the framework that provides the starting point of the experimental method and of the “how possibly” explanations he offers for material processes. Many have thought so.

In the Principles of Philosophy he goes so far as to attempt a derivation of the basic laws for planetary motions, based on the mechanistic supposition that the planets are material objects moved in circular fashion by vortices in a surrounding material fluid. Newton was soon enough to present his Mathematical Principles (Principia Mathematicae) to the world. Descartes had been able to present only a set of non-mathematical principles, but Newton demonstrated that the vortex account, whatever its pretensions to being established a priori, was, given his three laws of motion, inconsistent with the facts of elliptical orbits as established by observation by Kepler. After Newton had succeeded in his attempt to “demonstrate the frame of the system of the world” (as he set out to do in Book III of his Principia Mathematicae), little was heard, save for a rearguard of French Cartesians, of the vortex theory. It became an historical curiosity.

Be that as it may, it could be concluded that Descartes had merely misapplied his method a priori, not that it was incorrect. Some later thinkers such as William Whewell argued this point. The method did not disappear in the way the vortex theory disappeared.

b. Geometrical Deduction

In one sense, this method is like the method of geometry that Euclid had given to the world in that one began with self-evident truths as axioms and then deduced by equally self-evident steps a set of theorems. Descartes referred to this as the “synthetic method” of doing geometry and (he had hoped) physics. He attempted this in outline in the Discourse on Method and in detail in his Principles, taking as his axiom the existence of God as an unchanging and stable creator of the natural world. The mechanistic framework for carrying on empirical research followed.

However, there is the issue of how the premises are discovered. Euclid never showed how this was to be done. But the later Greek mathematician Pappus, to whom Descartes referred on the issue of method in the Rules for the Improvement of the Understanding, had suggested that the method of finding premises reversed as it were the deductions of the synthetic method. This was the “analytic method.” On the synthetic method one begins with premises that are accepted as true and works deductively towards conclusions, the theorems. Having reached the theorem, one has constructed a demonstration of that proposition. This synthetic method takes as given the premises from which it starts. But often to find a demonstration one must locate the premises from which the demonstration is to be constructed. This task of discovery was the point of the analytic method. On this method, one takes the conclusion to be demonstrated not as something accepted as true but merely as an hypothesis. One then works deductively towards the premises which one hopes to find for constructing a demonstration. Having arrived at the appropriate self-evident premises, one reverses the steps to obtain a synthetically organized demonstration of the hypothesis from which the analytic process started. And now that one has this demonstration, the proposition is transformed from a mere hypothesis to one that can be accepted as true. A particular version of the analytic method occurs in a reductio ad absurdum proof. Here one begins from an hypothesis and derives a contradiction; one then concludes that the hypothesis must be false, and that its denial is true. And as a special case of reductio ad absurdum, one begins with a proposition taken hypothetically and derives a conclusion that contradicts a known truth, concluding thereby that the original hypothesis is false. Descartes proposed to use this method to discover the axioms for his synthetic deductions: he is inspired by its uses in algebra, but extends it to his proof that the truths of geometry, arithmetic and physics, while self-evident, can themselves be demonstrated to be incorrigibly true from still more fundamental premises. The synthetic method was fine enough for the presentation of demonstrations in a science where the basic axioms are already known, and Descartes was to use this method, or thought he was so using it, in those parts of the Principles of Philosophy where he offered demonstrations of the basic truths of physics. Needless to say, his “proofs” have for the most part come to be seen as inadequate. But the analytic method was necessary from the discovery of the required premises. This is the method he proposes in the Discourse on Method as basic to firmly grounding the edifice of knowledge; and it is the method he uses in his presentation of the search after fundamental and incorrigible truths in the Meditations on First Philosophy, though here again he has generally been taken to be less successful in his application of the method than he himself hoped to be and expected he was. But his advocacy of the methods have continued to have their influence, in mathematics and algebra, and perhaps in physics, if not in first philosophy. Nevertheless, no one now expects to construct in either physics or geometry or first philosophy the rationalist ideal of an a priori demonstrative science.

c. Deduction in the Discourse and Meditations

As for the analytic method, Descartes was to use the first of the treatises appended to the Discourse on Method to illustrate the power of this method. This was the treatise on Geometry. This work in mathematics is remarkable, and it too was to revolutionize the way people thought about both algebra and geometry.

Descartes first set out to purify algebra. This was to be done by separating its patterns of thought from the particular subject matter to which it could be applied. He first separated what is given from which is to be discovered, developing the still current notation of a, b , c, … for known quantities and x, y, z, … for unknowns. He also reformed the notation for exponents replacing verbal terms such as “square” and “cube,” and so forth, by superscripts 23, , eliminating the geometrical connotations of the verbal terms. We continue to use this Cartesian notation.

Descartes then set out to apply this purified algebra in the solution of geometrical problems. The details need not concern us. For us it suffices to look at the problem he first addresses. This problem, which was posed originally by Pappus, is one of finding a curve of a point y relative to a point x, subject to certain geometrical constraints. To solve this problem he invents and uses the notion of a coordinate system. In effect he creates an arithmetical interpretation of geometry. (Descartes himself uses only an “x– axis”; the familiar extension of this idea to using two orthogonal “x” and “y” axes – what we now call “Cartesian coordinates” – were a later development of Descartes’ pioneering idea.) Descartes shows how the finding of this curve can be done algebraically by solving certain equations. The point for us is that the solving of an equation is a matter of applying Pappus’ “analytic method.” Given a, b, c, … , standing in certain arithmetical relations to one another, the equation in x and y asserts that there are values satisfying these conditions, that is, that there are solutions to the equation. This is the theorem to be proved. One proceeds by taking it as an hypothesis that x and y are solutions, and works out what those solutions are. This is the analytic process. Having found the solutions, one then has the premises from which the theorem to be proved follows. Deriving the theorem from the newly discovered premises is the synthetic process.

The algebraic methods that Descartes developed enabled him to present a series of entirely novel and original moves in geometry. Descartes’ work in its applications is itself significant, but what was revolutionary was the new methods for solving problems in geometry and algebra. It is easy to prove theorems, but the greatness of a mathematician is the new methods of proof that he or she introduces. By this standard Descartes was indeed a great mathematician. Thinking in terms of equations, one can see why Descartes valued the analytic method over the synthetic, for the latter amounted to a footnote to the former. The analytic method was the one to be used if one was aiming to discover new truths; once these are discovered the synthetic method can be used to present this knowledge to students. As a method for discovering truth, the synthetic procedure was largely useless, the searcher after truth will need, and will use, the analytic method. This why Descartes argues that the analytic method is the appropriate method for discovering the a priori necessary truths that are the starting point for any genuine science, not only a science like geometry but also as providing the necessary theoretical truths required by the eliminative methods of empirical experimental science.

Now, Descartes makes clear in the Discourse on Method that his starting point for his science and his physics is the existence of God. It is from the existence of God as stable and unchanging that he claims to be able to deduce, and thereby demonstrate, the basic laws of physics, the laws of motion and the laws describing the causes of changes in motion. That God is the starting point for his demonstrative science of physics is made even clearer in the Meditations. In both this and the Discourse, Descartes moves from his own existence to that of God, and then uses this as a premise from which his physics is deduced. It is evident that he is working with necessary truths and necessary inferences, or at least apparently necessary ones.

Descartes makes some important remarks in reply to some objections to the argument of theMeditations. Prior to publication of the Meditations, Descartes had circulated the manuscript to various other philosophers; they raised objections, and he wrote replies. He published his Meditations together with these Objections and Replies. In one of the Objections, the issue is raised why Descartes did not present his work in geometrical fashion, proceeding from axioms to theorems, using the synthetic method. In his Replies, Descartes explains he could have done so, but preferred to present his thoughts in the analytic method, which gives the order of discovery, through which the mind rises from hypotheses to the premises that are then used to prove synthetically the hypotheses that were the starting point of the inferences. He does, however, accede to the request of the Objection and does give a synthetically organized presentation of his inferences.

In this synthetic presentation the first proposition that he establishes is God’s existence, which he takes to be something involved in the very idea of God as a being who, of His own nature, has all perfections. He then proceeds to the causal arguments for God’s existence, and then to the proposition that God guarantees the truth of all propositions self-evidently implied by our ideas. Naturally enough this reverses the order of the Meditations themselves, which proceed in the order of the analytic method.

This means that the order of the Meditations is from propositions taken hypothetically to the proposition which is to form the first proposition to be discovered to be true and from which the hypotheses are then to be proved, that is, transformed from hypotheses to known truths.

Descartes reports in the First of the Meditations how he discovers that he can doubt almost everything about the material world that surrounds him. At the beginning of the Second Meditation his attention suddenly shifts from the world given in sense experience to the world given in inner awareness. He here discovers a proposition that he cannot doubt, namely the proposition that he expresses by “I think.” Since this thinking is a mode it must clearly be a mode of something, a substance: “I think, therefore I am.” Further, his thinking is inconceivable apart from himself, unlike, for example, extended things such as his body. He draws the further inference that he is a thinking thing. That is, he apparently is a substance, not a rational animal as Aristotle said, but a being or substance that is purely rational, one the essence of which is to aim to grasp the reasons for things. He carefully points out that this distinction between mind and body, based on the separability in thought of thinking from extension is only tentative. It may be that the world is not such as it here self-evidently appears to be. Thinking and extension may in the end be necessarily connected and it may be that modes can exist apart from substances, inconceivable though these things apparently seem to be. All this is to be here taken hypothetically, as a starting point in the analytic process leading to the discovery of a premise or premises that will serve to guarantee their truth and to justify the Meditator accepting them as truth.

It must be emphasized that Descartes does not, as so many seem to think, deduce the existence of God from the principle that “I think, therefore I am.” The latter is not a first truth from which all other knowledge is taken to follow, including our knowledge of God, as theorems proceed from axioms. To suppose this would be to suppose that the Meditations are organized in the order of a synthetic process, proceeding from known truths to true theorems that are deduced from those known truths. But Descartes clearly states that the order of the Meditations is that of the analytic method, from propositions taken hypothetically to simpler propositions which can then be used to prove deductively the hypotheses that were the starting point of the inferences. At the start of the process, one has only a proposition taken hypothetically. So the Meditator’s own existence is a mere hypothesis, not a known truth, as is the premise from which it derives that all properties or modes exist only in substances.

This is where the Meditator is at the beginning of the Third Meditation. He or she can conclude, however, that as he or she is an imperfect being. Being a being that aims to know the doubt with which he or she is presently seized, it is clear he or she does not exist as his or her essence naturally implies that he or she should exist but lacks something the presence of which would be his or her Good. The idea that one has of oneself is that of an imperfect being; but to conceive an imperfect being requires one to be able to conceive a perfect being, just as conceiving something to be a non-square requires one to have the idea of a square. The presence of the negative idea requires the presence of the positive idea. So, the Meditator has the idea of a being that lacks no Good, no perfection–for any way of being this entity has that way either actually or formally. (Recall here that an idea, which, as Descartes speaks, formally exists as a property of the mind, exists objectively as the form or essence of a substance; the idea is true only if that the substance of which it is the essence actually exists in sense that it has actually the properties the essence determines that it ought to have; the idea is false if the substance has properties contrary to those that the essence requires it to have.)

The Meditator now infers the existence of such a perfect being from the fact that he as a finite being must be caused by such a perfect being, and from the fact that he or she could have present in his or her thoughts the idea of such a being only if it were placed there by such a being. But the existence of a perfect being is only established hypothetically – the arguments depend upon causal principles that, while self-evident, have not yet been established as true – following hypothetically from propositions that are themselves only hypothesis, the existence of God at this point in the inferences of the Meditations can only be an hypothesis – a further stage as one is led on by the analytic method to the discovery of what one hopes will be a truth upon which all other truths can be made demonstratively to rest.

The Fourth Meditation is a sort of aside in which Descartes clears away an apparent difficulty. There appears to be an inconsistency between the idea of a perfect being causing one with the idea that one falls into error and doubt: shouldn’t a perfect being create beings that do not fail to be what essentially they ought to be? Descartes replies that such error is not caused by God but by ourselves. Located in a world that often hastens us on, we must regularly conclude before full evidence is available. Our will moves us to judge and such judgments often outrun what reason can justify. Now, God has given us free will, and this is a greater good than is mere avoidance of error. God’s will does not cause us to err, it is our own will that does that, so the idea of a perfect God creating us is compatible with our being beings that fall into error. The apparent difficulty disappears, and we can return to the process of analysis that is, one hopes, leading one to a premise which can serve to demonstrate the hypotheses through which one is being led by a series of apparently necessary connections.

This brings us to the Fifth Meditation. Thinking of oneself as a finite being one is led to the idea of God and then to the idea of God as one’s creator and as one who is created with the idea of such a perfect being within oneself. But now before one’s mind is the idea of a being with creative powers that lacks nothing, lacks no perfection. It must therefore in particular cause itself to be and to be in this state of full perfection. But if it has the creative power to maintain itself as a being which lacks nothing, if, in other words, it is a being which as a creating being is infinitely powerful, then there is nothing else that could cause it not to be in any way at all. We have within us this idea and as we plumb its depths we recognize that this is an idea of a being the creative powers of which guarantee that it exists, it is the idea of a being that guarantees the truth of this very idea. Our other ideas are ideas of finite beings none of which can guarantee their own existence and the ideas of which might therefore be false; but this one idea, this one essence that is before the mind, is the idea of a being infinite in its creative powers and which is therefore the essence of a being that can guarantee its own existence, which in turn therefore guarantees the truth of the idea of itself.

Here, then, in the existence of God, we have reached the end point of our analytic process in a truth which guarantees its own truth and upon which all other truths can be made to rest. This truth can therefore form the incorrigible base upon which all our knowledge claims can be made to rest. Descartes can now hastily draw things to a close: God as a perfect being, could not create non-being: it is a contradiction to suppose non-being could be brought into being. But for a rational being, a thinking substance, to err is for it to not know: it is a form of non-being. So God could not create a rational being for which principles clearly and distinctly perceived to be true were after all false: that would be to create a being which systematically erred about the structure of the world. So what is clear and distinct, what is self-evident, and compels its acceptance by the Meditator and indeed by any rational being, is guaranteed to be true. In particular, the laws of geometry, of extended substance, are guaranteed to be true. And further, the incompatibility of thought and extension as essence of substances, which, in the SecondMeditation, while clear and distinct, is only apparently true can now be affirmed as not merely apparently true but as actually true.

With God, we have reached at the conclusion of the analytic process the starting point of the synthetic presentation that Descartes gives in his Replies to the Objections. In that synthetic presentation, the sequence ends with the conclusion (theorem) that what is clear and distinct must be true.

Two points need to be mentioned. First, the move of “I think, therefore I am” (cogito, ergo sum) is not a direct insight into the Meditator’s own being. It is, rather, an inference, based on the principle that every mode (property) exists only if it is in a substance. Since it is based on a metaphysical principle the truth of which has not yet been established, it could not provide a starting point for constructing the edifice of knowledge.

Second, the existence of God is in the end not established by argument. The so-called ontological argument of the Fifth Meditation is not in fact an argument. It is rather a case where we have direct insight into the essence of God – what is formally the idea of God is objectively the essence of God – , where we recognize that here we have an essence that guarantees its own existence as an infinitely powerful being and thereby guarantees the truth of the idea through which we think it. Other ideas we have are no doubt true, but none save this one alone guarantees its own truth – guarantees it in a way that requires no argument. With God we reach a point where no further premises are either available or needed.

The Cartesian method to science thus indeed yields an a priori science. It is a deductive method but one that involves both analysis and synthesis.

3. Method of Doubt

We have so far studiously avoided one feature of the Cartesian method. This is the so-called “method of doubt.” Descartes takes very seriously the notion that progress in science will be hindered if we allow our minds to be clouded by the worthless standards inherited from the past and from our teachers. Thus, he begins the Geometry with his clarification of the notion of a power, removing the irrelevant geometrical connotations attached to expressions like “x cubed” and replacing them with the perspicuous notation of “x3” that we continue to use to this day. Again, he believed it to be important to shed ourselves of all forms of teleological thinking – he chastised Harvey for falling away from the mechanistic reasoning he used to establish the circulation of the blood and into teleological thinking when he came to discuss the action of the heart.

He therefore recommended that one undertake a cleansing intellectual project in the attempt to move towards truth by first eliminating error and indeed all possibility of error. This could be done by rejecting as false all propositions that could in any way be doubted. This is Descartes’ first rule of method in theDiscourse on Method. This is stated as the injunction:

[N]ever to accept anything as true if I did not have evident knowledge of its truth: that is, carefully to avoid precipitate conclusions and preconceptions, and to include nothing more in my judgments than what presented itself to my mind so clearly and so distinctly that I had no occasion to doubt it.

By eliminating all dubitable beliefs, truths would of course be excised along with the false, but then in the re-building of the edifice of knowledge that was to follow those truths would be recovered, free from the errors of the past.

This was an exercise to be undertaken by oneself, simply taking oneself to be a rational being. But if one is rational, one is also animal, even if being an animal is not part of one’s essence. The animal makes demands – one must eat and drink, one must sleep, perchance to dream, one must live with others, one might even take a lover. One could not do this if all beliefs were eliminated. So Descartes also recommends that one go along with this second best, the beliefs that one needs to survive and to have a decent and pleasant life – interrupted only occasionally by bouts of meditating on the foundations of knowledge, or the basic laws of physics – just as one must in the end do science empirically, through observation and experiment, even though it is only uncertainly founded. Reason demands for itself the method of doubt, but the remainder of one’s being makes unavoidable demands that require one to ignore the promptings of reason to try to doubt everything. The reasonable person will accede to those demands, just as reason must attempt a universal doubt. It is also part of Descartes’ method that one does accede to those extra-rational demands. The reasonable person could not do otherwise: there is in the end more to being human than simply being rational.

It is remarkable, however, just how far Descartes, while meditating, is prepared to take the doubt his method recommends. In the Discourse on Method he seems to stop with what is self-evident, what is clear and distinct: he seems to assume is true, and therefore makes this his starting point. In theMeditations, he takes the doubt a step further, finding a way to call into doubt even what is most evident. His model is the traditional doctrine of transubstantiation according to which the bread and wine during the saying of the mass is miraculously transformed by God into the body and blood of Christ. The sensible appearances remain the same, but the substance changes in its essence. The heretic and unbeliever will be deceived by appearances into thinking no change has occurred. But the good Christian knows that whatever be the sensible appearances what is really there is the body and blood of Christ. His or her faith prevents him or her from falling into the error of the heretic and the unbeliever. Indeed, it is out of God’s goodness that the heretic and the unbeliever be deceived in this way, since if they realized what was really happening, that the body and blood of Christ were being consumed, they could charge the Christian with the sin, horrid to conceive, of cannibalism.

So Descartes at least takes Thomas Aquinas’ account of transubstantiation seriously and uses it as a model. He creates the hypothesis that there is a powerful being who has the capacity to deceive me into thinking that world is not as my clear and distinct ideas make it out to be when in fact in its essence it is something else. One hypothesizes that there is a powerful being, like God no doubt, but instead an evil genius, intent on deceiving one about the basic ontological structure of being. In fact, the hypothesis is sufficiently strong to make is possible that I am deceived about my own being, that contrary to what appears to me to be true, that cogito ergo sum holds, it really does not and I am really something essentially different from the thinking thing that I appear to me to be. (Descartes makes clear at the beginning of the Third Meditation that the hypothesis of the evil genius calls even the cogito into question.)

So we have the structure of the Meditations as follows:

[Hypothesis:] There is an evil genius who is deceiving me about the truth of clear and distinct ideas. [From this hypothesis I now infer] if I am being deceived, then I am thinking; if I am thinking, then I exist; if I (as a finite creature) exist, then there exists a God (an infinite being) who creates me; – [here the existence of God is hypothetical, but having reached the idea of God as an infinite cause of all being, including myself, I can see as I grasp this idea that it non-hypothetically requires its own truth] – God (as an infinite creator) guarantees His own being and therefore exist – [here we have reached a certain and incorrigible categorical truth]; but [now upon this truth all other truths hinge] an infinite being is a perfect being and therefore cannot create finite beings who are systematically deceived; therefore our clear and distinct ideas are true; therefore there is no evil genius.

The Meditations thus have the form of an analytic structure of a reductio ad absurdum of the hypothesis of the evil genius who systematically deceives me: I find in God that necessary truth which contradicts and therefore eliminates the hypothesis of the evil genius. The method of doubt is solved by Descartes to his own satisfaction, but to few others. For him it was a way to purge the mind of inherited prejudice, and therefore merely a first and preliminary step on the way to truth. It was clear to him that if one stopped there then one had fallen into a skeptical morass – a skepticism close to that into which Montaigne had suggested was the inevitable fate of the human intellect, it was human hubris to think that one could really know anything. One had to settle for such mere belief and opinion that one could learn from experience of the ordinary world – which was also the position Descartes recommended for the human being to fall back into while undertaking the intellectual exercise of the method of doubt. Descartes felt he could find the natural light of reason and move out of Montaigne’s skeptical morass – he felt that the illumination began with his discovery that cogito, ergo sum, and from there was led on by that light of reason to discover its source in God and to discover in that source a firm point on which to tie down incorrigible and indubitable knowledge of the rational structure of the world.

4. Conclusion

Many now see Descartes as having posed the skeptical challenge that still confronts philosophers, with the hypothesis of the evil genius taking the skeptical challenge as far, or as deep, as it can go. For Descartes, however, it was more like the deep night through which the soul must pass on its way to light, the light of reason, and to God as the reason for all things and the source of that light, and then, through God, to the scientific study of the world. Few have been able to follow him: he has not convinced. For most, the radical skepticism created by Descartes’ method of doubt and the demon hypothesis is a sham: Descartes creates the problem for himself when he suggests that the world can be distinguished ontologically into the world of ordinary experience and a world of essences or forms that lies beyond this ordinary world but which constitutes the reasons for its being. If the reasons for our ordinary world being as it is are not to be found in that world, then they are not to be found at all, and the radical skepticism is a consequence of a search after what cannot be found: the skepticism is not there to be conquered, as Descartes thought, but to be dismissed as an unreasonable longing for a world of certainty that is not there.

But if we say this, then we must also say that method of doubt is not wholly to be dismissed in this way. While the radical skepticism that Descartes proposes cannot be reasonable, we should nonetheless take his method seriously enough that we remain diffident in our judgments – that we not take things dogmatically, but rather critically, ready to recognize evidence that can challenge the rational acceptability of those judgments. So long as we do not take ‘clear’ and ‘distinct’ as rigidly as Descartes does, it is not a bad rule “to include nothing more in one’s judgments than what presents itself to one’s mind so clearly and distinctly that one has no reason to doubt it” (to paraphrase Descartes’ rule in the Discourse). This is what reasonable persons do. It is now the norm, it was not the norm before Descartes.

Nor, taking Descartes’ other rules of method just as cautiously, is it difficult to see the wisdom in these rules of method – the rules in the Discourse that one should “divide each of the difficulties examined into as many parts as possible and as may be required in order to resolve them better”; that one ought “to direct one’s thoughts in an orderly manner, by beginning with the simplest and most easily known objects in order to ascend little by little, step by step, to knowledge of the most complex, and by supposing some order even among objects that have no natural order of precedence”; and that one ought “throughout to make enumerations so complete, and reviews so comprehensive, so that one could be sure of leaving nothing out.” Following these rule may not lead one to discover the existence of God, as Descartes thought, but they remain rules that recommend themselves to searchers after any sort of truth about the world, even where those truths are metaphysically more modest than those that Descartes sought.

This was perhaps the most important contribution of Descartes to the opening up of thought in the modern and early modern period. If Descartes was not as modest in his cognitive aspirations as his method of doubt requires, then that only shows that Descartes too had his failings as a human being – it is not to denigrate the contribution he made to the emergence of the modern mind as one that is committed to finding truth, and that is open, and ready to submit to criticism. Descartes’ rationalism has had its day; few would now advocate the method a priori that he advocated. Yet, if they are taken cautiously, the Cartesian precepts for the search after truth that he presents in the Discourse on Method can still be recommended for the clarity of thought that results from our conforming to these standards.

Science is no longer something that aims to become a priori and incorrigibly certain. But Descartes also saw science as a human enterprise in which the search after truth is rooted in observation and experiment. This part of the Cartesian vision remains with us. So, too, does his notion that progress towards truth comes through the testing of hypotheses and the elimination of the false through the production in experiments, deliberate or natural, of counterexamples. Of course, this idea, that science searches after truth through the elimination of error, was not Descartes’ alone. He shared it with Bacon. Indeed, Bacon’s vision was in one respect clearer, since he did not see the need to root the scientific theories that guide research into some a priori ontological structure of being. The theories that guide research are simply laws among laws – to be sure, they are laws about laws, but for all that they are empirical generalizations like any other law.

At the same time, it must be said that Descartes was much the better at applying the experimental method that both he and Bacon advocated. Descartes made real contributions to empirical science, for example, in optics and in the physiology of the eyeball, where Bacon made no such contribution.

Moreover, the Cartesian vision of the world as one to be understood in terms of physical mechanisms, while no longer taken to be one that needs any a priori defense of the sort Descartes himself proposed, has become and remains as the basic framework of science: if it has not been confirmed a priori, it has certainly been confirmed a posteriori, and it is still the guiding vision of science – this in spite of the challenges, still often to be heard, that the complexity of this or that cannot be reduced to, or be understood in terms of, “mechanistic materialism.” In the years after Descartes’ death, his mechanistic formulations of problems in physiology swept out the obfuscating categories of the older forms of thought, of teleology in particular, in ways that could not be circumvented. Some tenured professors in the universities continued to hang on to the old scholastic ways of thought, but elsewhere the new science of Descartes swept away the dross. The modern science of physiology was created by the Cartesian vision, and in fact is still sustained by it – though, to be sure, physics is no longer simply a science of mechanical motions, it has grown to include quantum mechanics and molecular biology – but physics is still a science that enables us to say that science of physiology is no different in kind from the sciences of stones and of atoms and of planets.

Descartes’ own contributions to physics, both in optics and mechanics, were considerable. In mechanics, his work was definitely blocked by his failure to even think that a notion of mass was essential to any mechanics that was to move from kinematics to dynamics. In optics, his mechanistic ideas clearly interfered with his attempts to understand colors. These problems, in both mechanics and optics, awaited Newton for their solution.

In mathematics his contributions remain with us to this day, not merely as part of a guiding vision – though that is certainly there – but as part of the working tools of every mathematician. One has only to think of his innovations in notation, for example, of exponents, or the methods of analytic geometry, for example, the use of a system of (“Cartesian”) coordinates. Modern algebra and modern geometry are inconceivable without Descartes’ contributions. The mathematics and mathematical methods that he invented shaped his reflections on the proper method in science and in philosophy. It is also true, one must add, that his reflections on the methods proper to philosophy shaped his work in algebra and geometry.

Descartes’ reflections on the methods proper to science and to philosophy were, as he himself claimed, highly original, and highly influential. They shape our thinking about these same things up to the present, and will no doubt continue to shape them. They amount to the demand that we seek clarity in our thought, that we be diffident rather than dogmatic in our judgments, that when we search after truth then we should do so systematically, from the simpler to the complex, in a way befitting the subject matter, and that a science like physiology is to be understood as in no way different in kind from the science of stones. If we ignore these Cartesian precepts of method, then that is to our own peril, or at least to the impoverishment of our own thought.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Descartes’ complete works can be found in Oeuvres de Descartes. Ed. C. Adam and P. Tannery. 12 vols. (Paris: J. Vrin, 1897-1913; reprinted 1964-1974).
    • See also the Correspondance. Publiée avec une introd. et des notes, par Ch. Adam et G. Milhaud, 8 vols. (Paris: F. Alcan, 1936-63).
  • Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings. 3 vols. Vols 1 and 2 trans. J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff and D. Murdoch; vol. 3 trans J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff, D. Murdoch, and A. Kenny (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, vols. 1 and 2, 1984, vol. 3, 1992).
    • This is now the standard English translation. Vol. 1 contains Early WritingsRules for the Direction of Our Native IntelligenceThe World and Treatise on ManDiscourse on Method and (in part) the appended treatises on OpticsGeometry, and Meteorology;Principles of Philosophy (in part); Comments on a Certain BroadsheetDescription of the Human Body; and The Passions of the Soul. Vol. 2 contains (in full) the Meditations on First Philosophy and the Objections and Replies. Vol. 3 contains much of the philosophically and scientifically interesting portions of Descartes’ correspondence.
  • Descartes, René. Discourse on Method, Optics, Geometry, and Meteorology. Trans. with Intro. by Paul J. Olscamp. (Indianapolis, IN: Bobbs-Merrill, 1965)
    • This contains complete English translations of the Discourse on Method and the three appended treatises.
  • Descartes, René. Principles of Philosophy. Trans. with Notes by V. R. Miller and R. P. Millar. (Synthese Historical Library – Texts and Studies in the History of Logic and Philosophy, vol. 24. Dordrecht, The Netherlands: D. Reidel, 1983).
    • This contains a complete English translation of the 1644 text.

b. Bibliographical Study

  • Sebba, G. Bibliographica Cartesianae: A Critical Guide to the Descartes Literature, 1800-1958(The Hague: Nijhoff, 1964).
    • An indispensable bibliography.

c. Secondary Sources

  • Roger. Descartes’ Meditations: Background Source Materials. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998).
  • Beck, L. J. The Method of Descartes: A Study of the Regulae. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1952).
  • Broughton, Janet. Descartes’s Method of Doubt. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2002).
  • Cottingham, John, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Descartes. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992).
  • Crombie, A. C., “The Mechanistic Hypothesis and the Scientific Study of Vision,” Proceedings of the Royal Microscopical Society, 2 (1907), pp. 3-112.
  • Curley, E. M. Descartes Against the Skeptics. (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1978).
  • Foster, Michael. Lectures on the History of Physiology, during the Sixteenth, Seventeenth and Eighteenth Centuries. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1901).
  • Garber, Daniel. “Semel in vita: The Scientific Background to Descartes’ Meditations.” In Essays on Descartes’ Meditations, ed. Amélie Oksenberg Rorty. (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1986).
  • Garber, Daniel. Descartes’ Metaphysical Physics. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1992).
  • Gaukroger, Stephen. Cartesian Logic: An Essay on Descartes’s Conception of Inference. (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1989).
  • Gewirtz, A. “Experience and the Non-Mathematical in the Cartesian Method,” Journal of the History of Ideas, 2 (1941), pp. 183-210.
  • Hall, Thomas J. Ideas of Life and Matter. 2 vols. (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1969).
    • The impact of Cartesian ideas in the seventeenth century is discussed in vol. 1.
  • Gaukroger, Stephen, ed. Descartes: Philosophy, Mathematics and Physics. (Sussex: The Harvester Press, 1980).
  • Gilson, Étienne. Études sur le Role de la Pensée Médiévale dans la Formation du Système Cartésien (Paris: J. Vrin, 1930).
  • Gilson, Étienne. René Descartes’ Discours de la Méthode; Texte et Commentaire. (Paris: Librairie Philosophique J. Vrin, 1947).
  • Grant, Edward. Much Ado about Nothing: Theories of Space and Vacuum from the Middle Ages to the Scientific Revolution. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981).
  • Koyré, Alexandre. Entretiens sur Descartes. (New York: Brentano’s, 1944).
  • Koyré, Alexandre. From the Closed World to the Infinite Universe. (Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1957).
  • Lennon, Thomas. The Battle of the Gods and Giants: the Legacies of Descartes and Gassendi, 1655-1715. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1993).
  • Popkin, Richard H. The History of Scepticism from Erasmus to Spinoza. (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1979).
  • Smith, Norman Kemp. New Studies in the Philosophy of Descartes: Descartes as Pioneer. (London: Macmillan, 1952). Voss, Stephen. ed. Essays on the Philosophy and Science of René Descartes (Oxford University Press, 1993).
  • Wilson, Fred. The Logic and Methodology of Science in Early Modern Thought: Seven Studies (Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1999).
  • Wilson, Margaret D. Descartes. (London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1978).

Author Information

Fred Wilson
Email: fwilson@chass.utoronto.ca
University of Toronto
Canada

Doxastic Voluntarism

Doxastic voluntarism is the philosophical doctrine according to which people have voluntary control over their beliefs. Philosophers in the debate about doxastic voluntarism distinguish between two kinds of voluntary control. The first is known as direct voluntary control and refers to acts which are such that if a person chooses to perform them, they happen immediately. For instance, a person has direct voluntary control over whether he or she is thinking about his or her favorite song at a given moment. The second is known as indirect voluntary control and refers to acts which are such that although a person lacks direct voluntary control over them, he or she can cause them to happen if he or she chooses to perform some number of other, intermediate actions. For instance, a person untrained in music has indirect voluntary control over whether he or she will play a melody on a violin. Corresponding to this distinction between two kinds of voluntary control, philosophers distinguish between two kinds of doxastic voluntarism. Direct doxastic voluntarism claims that people have direct voluntary control over at least some of their beliefs. Indirect doxastic voluntarism, however, supposes that people have indirect voluntary control over at least some of their beliefs, for example, by doing research and evaluating evidence.

This article offers an introductory explanation of the nature of belief, the nature of voluntary control, the reasons for the consensus regarding indirect doxastic voluntarism, the reasons for the disagreements regarding direct doxastic voluntarism, and the practical implications for the debate about doxastic voluntarism in ethics, epistemology, political theory, and the philosophy of religion.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Indirect Doxastic Voluntarism
  3. Direct Doxastic Voluntarism
    1. Arguments against Direct Doxastic Voluntarism
      1. The Classic Argument
      2. The Empirical Belief Argument
      3. The Intentional Acts Argument
      4. The Contingent Inability Argument
    2. Arguments for Direct Doxastic Voluntarism
      1. The Observed Ability Argument
      2. The Action Analogy Argument
  4. Significance: Ethical, Epistemological, Political, and Religious
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The central issue in the debate about doxastic voluntarism is the relationship between willing and acquiring beliefs. Necessarily related to this central issue are two other important issues: the nature of belief and the nature of the will, or more specifically, the nature of voluntary control. In order to provide a basic foundation for understanding the central issue, let us begin by clarifying each of these related issues.

First, let us make a preliminary and necessarily cursory clarification about the nature of belief. Consider your own case. Assuming that you are like most people, you believe a wide variety of things. Among the various things you believe, is one of them that the sum of thirty-seven and three is forty? If all went well, as you read and replied to that question, two things happened: (i) you comprehended the proposition the sum of thirty-seven and three is forty—that is, it was immediately present to your mind, you understood it, and you actively considered it, etc.—and (ii) you answered affirmatively. In light of such examples, philosophers have traditionally characterized the nature of belief as follows. To say that a person believes a proposition is to say that, at a given moment, the person both comprehends and affirms the proposition. It is in this sense that Augustine claims, “To believe is nothing but to think with assent” (Augustine, De Praedestione Sanctorum, v; cf. Aquinas, Summa Theologicae II-II, Q. 2, a. 1; Descartes, Meditations IV, Principles of Philosophy I.34; Russell 1921. For a detailed discussion of the nature of assent, see, for example, Newman 1985.).

This traditional characterization is a reasonable starting point for understanding the nature of belief, but it is at the very least incomplete. To see why, reflect on your own experience of considering the above-raised question. Both prior to and subsequent to considering the question, the proposition the sum of thirty-seven and three is forty was neither immediately present to your mind nor something you were actively considering. Nonetheless, you still believed it, and you still believe it. In this respect, you are like most other people. There are, as a matter of fact, some propositions that people believe about which they are currently thinking and others that they believe about which they are not currently thinking. To account for this fact, let us amend the traditional characterization of belief. To say that a person believes some proposition is to say that, at a given moment, the person either

i) comprehends and affirms the proposition, or

ii) is disposed to comprehend and to affirm the proposition (cf. Audi 1994, Price 1954, Ryle 2000, Scott-Kakures 1994, Schwitzgebel 2002).

There are, as one might expect, a number of subtle and controversial issues regarding the nature of belief that one could raise at this point, and addressing such issues would certainly be important in developing a complete theory about doxastic voluntarism. This amended description of belief should be sufficient, however, for our introductory discussion.

Second, let us make a preliminary and, again, necessarily cursory clarification about the nature of voluntary control. Take a moment to visualize the White House or to imagine the melody of your favorite song. Such mental activities are not difficult. Assuming your mental faculties are functioning properly, if you choose to perform these actions, they will happen immediately. They are things over which you have, what we will call, direct voluntary control. Suppose, however, that you want to learn either to play a particular song on a musical instrument on which you are currently untrained or to say a particular phrase in a foreign language that you do not currently speak. You will not acquire these abilities immediately after choosing to do so. Rather, you will have to choose to engage in a series of acts (for example, attending lessons, practicing, etc.) that will eventually result in your acquiring of these abilities. So, you do not have direct voluntary control over whether you can play a musical instrument or learn a foreign language. Nonetheless, acquiring abilities such as these is something that you choose to do. Thus, it is something over which you have a form of voluntary control—namely, what we will call, indirect voluntary control.

As with the nature of belief, at this point one could raise a number of subtle and controversial issues regarding the nature of voluntary control, and addressing such issues would surely be important in developing a complete theory about doxastic voluntarism. (For related discussions of these issues, see, for example, Alston 1989, Steup 2000, Nottelmann 2006.) Nonetheless, this distinction between direct and indirect voluntary control should be sufficient for our introductory discussion.

Corresponding to this distinction between direct and indirect voluntary control, philosophers distinguish between direct doxastic voluntarism and indirect doxastic voluntarism. The former is concerned with answering the question: to what extent, if any, do people have direct voluntary control over their beliefs? The latter is concerned with answering the question: to what extent, if any, do people have indirect voluntary control over their beliefs? Since the debate about indirect doxastic voluntarism is less contentious, let us examine it first.

2. Indirect Doxastic Voluntarism

Is indirect doxastic voluntarism true? Consider the following cases. First, suppose you walk into a room that is dark but has a working light that you can turn on by flipping the switch on the wall. When you walk into the room, you believe the proposition the light in the room is off. You realize, though, that you could change your belief by flipping the switch, so you flip the switch. The light comes on, and subsequently, you believe the proposition the light in the room is on. Second, suppose a usually trustworthy friend tells you that Paul David Hewson is one of the most popular singers of all time. You have no idea who this Hewson fellow is, but you would like to know whether you should trust your friend and, hence, believe the proposition Paul David Hewson is one of the most popular singers of all time. So, you do some research and discover that Paul David Hewson is the legal name of the incredibly popular lead singer for the Irish rock band U2. Consequently, you come to believe that Paul David Hewson is one of the most popular singers of all time. Thus, there are at least two cases in which someone has indirect voluntary control over his or her beliefs.

These cases, however, are not unique. The first illustrates that people have indirect voluntary control over whether they will believe any proposition, if they have voluntary control over the evidence confirming or disconfirming the proposition. The second illustrates that people have indirect voluntary control over whether they will believe many propositions, provided that they can discover evidence confirming or disconfirming these propositions, that they choose to seek out this evidence, and that they form their beliefs according to the evidence.

The significance of cases such as these is widely recognized among participants in the debate about doxastic voluntarism. (For summaries of such cases, see, for example, Alston 1989, Feldman 2001.) In fact, they are so widely accepted that philosophers seem to have reached a consensus on one aspect of the debate, recognizing that indirect doxastic voluntarism is true. In light of this consensus, they focus the majority of their attention on the more contentious question of direct doxastic voluntarism, to which we will now turn.

3. Direct Doxastic Voluntarism

Is direct doxastic voluntarism true? On this issue, philosophers are divided. Many argue that it is not, but some argue that it is. To each position, however, there are important challenges. Let us consider the most influential arguments and counterarguments in some detail, beginning with arguments against direct doxastic voluntarism.

a. Arguments against Direct Doxastic Voluntarism

i. The Classic Argument

Bernard Williams (1970) offers two arguments against direct doxastic voluntarism. Call the first “The Classic Argument,” since it is, perhaps, the locus classicus of the debate. Call the second “The Empirical Belief Argument,” since the notion of empirical belief is its essential feature.

The Classic Argument runs as follows: If people could believe propositions at will, then they could judge propositions to be true regardless of whether they thought the propositions were, in fact, true. Moreover, they would know that they had this power—that is, the power to form a judgment regarding a proposition regardless of whether they thought it was true. For instance, direct doxastic voluntarism seems to imply that, at this very moment, Patti could form the belief that Oswald killed Kennedy regardless of whether, at this very moment, she regards the proposition Oswald killed Kennedy as true or as false. Moreover, if direct doxastic voluntarism is correct, then it seems that Patti would know that she has the power to form a judgment regarding the proposition Oswald killed Kennedy regardless of whether she considers the proposition to be true. This phenomenon, however, is at odds with the nature of belief for the following reason. If a person believes that a proposition is true, then he or she would be surprised (or experience some related form of cognitive dissonance) to discover that the proposition is false. Similarly, if a person believes that a proposition is false, then he or she would be surprised (or experience some related form of cognitive dissonance) to discover that the proposition is true. For instance, if Patti believes that Oswald killed Kennedy, then she would experience some form of cognitive dissonance upon discovering that C.I.A. operatives killed Kennedy. Similarly, if Patti believes that Oswald did not kill Kennedy, then she would experience some form of cognitive dissonance upon discovering that he did. Thus, people could not seriously think of the beliefs they set out to acquire at will as beliefs—such as the things that “purport to represent reality.” Thus, Williams continues,

With regard to no belief could I know—or, if all this is to be done in full consciousness, even suspect—that I had acquired it at will. But if I can acquire beliefs at will, I must know that I am able to do this; and could I know that I was capable of this feat, if with regard to every feat of this kind which I had performed I necessarily had to believe that it had not taken place? (1970, 108)

Williams suggests that the answer to his rhetorical question is clear: ‘no’. It follows that such a person would not know that he or she is capable of acquiring beliefs at will and, hence, that such a person could not acquire beliefs at will. Therefore, Williams suggests, direct doxastic voluntarism is not merely false; rather it is conceptually impossible (1970, 108).

Critics, however, argue that The Classic Argument has at least three major flaws. First, they suggest that there is a difference between belief acquisition and belief fixation. It is at least possible that at one moment a person could will, in full consciousness, to acquire a belief concerning a proposition merely for practical reasons, regardless of the truth of the proposition. Once the person does this, however, he or she might perceive the evidence for the proposition differently than before—such that he or she comes to perceive some fact, which previously seemed like a terrible evidence for the proposition, as conclusive evidence for the proposition. In which case, the person’s belief would be fixed for theoretical reasons that are concerned with the truth of the proposition. Thus, the person might perceive his or her previous position as a kind of doxastic blindness, in which he or she failed to recognize the evidence for what it really is—namely, conclusive evidence. Hence, it is possible that at one moment a person could will, in full consciousness, to acquire a belief regardless of the truth of the proposition, and in the next moment regard his or her belief as a belief and believe that his or her belief was acquired at will just a moment ago. Therefore, critics conclude, The Classic Argument fails (cf. Johnston 1995, 438; Winters 1979, 253; see also Scott-Kakures 1994).

Second, they contend that a person could know, in general, that he or she had the ability to acquire beliefs at will without knowing that any particular belief was acquired at will. Jonathan Bennett illustrates the objection nicely with a thought experiment involving a group of fictional characters called ‘Credamites’. According to Bennett’s tale,

Credam is a community each of whose members can be immediately induced to acquire beliefs. It doesn’t happen often, because they don’t often think: ‘I don’t believe that p, but it would be good if I did.’ Still, such thoughts come to them occasionally, and on some of those occasions the person succumbs to temptation and will himself to have the desired belief. […] When a Credamite gets a belief in this way, he forgets that this is how he came by it. The belief is always one that he has entertained and has thought to have some evidence in its favour; though in the past he has rated the counter-evidence more highly, he could sanely have inclined the other way. When he wills himself to believe, that is what happens: he wills himself to find the other side more probable. After succeeding, he forgets that he willed himself to do it. (1990, 93)

To understand, more clearly, how Bennett’s Credamites can exercise direct voluntary control over their beliefs, consider a particular (hypothetical) case. Suppose there is a Credamite who is very ill and who finds it possible, but less than likely, that she will recover from her illness. Nonetheless, her chances of recovery will increase if she believes that she will recover from her illness, and she is aware of this connection between her beliefs and her illness. So, as any rational Credamite might, she simply chooses to believe that she will recover and, consequently, forgets that she willed herself to form the belief. Thus, Bennett’s thought experiment suggests that, contrary to what Williams claims, there could be beings who have the ability to form beliefs at will, choose to exercise that ability on a specific occasion, and immediately forget that they exercised their ability on that occasion (see also Scott-Kakures 1994, 83; Winters 1979, 255). Therefore, he and sympathetic critics conclude, The Classic Argument fails.

Third, they contend that a person could possess an ability without knowing that he or she possesses the ability (see, for example, Winters 1979, 255). Thus, a person could have the ability to acquire beliefs at will even if it were impossible for her to know that he or she had this kind of ability. Therefore, the critics conclude, The Classic Argument fails.

ii. The Empirical Belief Argument

The Empirical Belief Argument against direct doxastic voluntarism runs as follows. A person can have an empirical belief concerning a proposition only if the proposition is true and the person’s perceptual organs are working correctly to cause the belief. For example, a woman can have an empirical belief, say, that the walls in her office are white only if the walls in her office are, in fact, white and her eyes are working correctly to cause the belief. In cases of believing empirical matters at will, “there would be no regular connection between the environment, the perceptions,” and the belief. Thus, believing at will would fail to satisfy the necessary conditions of ‘empirical belief’. Therefore, believing empirical matters at will is conceptually impossible (Williams 1970, 108).

Critics suggest that there are at least two problems with The Empirical Belief Argument. First, people believe all sorts of things about empirical matters that are not caused by the state of affairs obtaining and their perceptual organs functioning properly (cf. Bennett 1990, 94-6). For instance, one might believe that a tower in the distance is round because it seems round to one whose perceptual organs are functioning properly—even though at this distance square towers appear round. Hence, the argument seems to rely on a false premise. Second, even if the argument were sound, it would show only that it is impossible for people to will to believe some propositions. Therefore, the critics contend, even if The Empirical Belief Argument were sound, it would show only that certain beliefs are not within one’s voluntary control, not that direct doxastic voluntarism is false, let alone conceptually impossible.

The problem, however, might seem merely to be Williams’ suggestion that a person can have an empirical belief concerning a proposition only if the proposition is true. Supporters of The Empirical Belief Argument, however, could reject that claim and offer a revised version of the argument. In fact, Louis Pojman has offered such an argument, which runs as follows (Pojman 1999, 576-9). Acquiring a belief is typically a happening in which the world forces itself on a subject. A happening in which the world forces itself on a subject is not a thing the subject does or chooses. Therefore, acquiring a belief is not typically something a subject does or chooses.

Critics contend, however, that there are at least two problems with Pojman’s version of the argument. First, they contend that people do have some direct form of voluntary control over their beliefs they form in light of sensory experiences. For instance, someone might have a very strong sensory experience suggesting that there is an external world and, nonetheless, not judge that there is an external world. Rather, one might suspend judgment about the matter (see, for example, Descartes’s First Meditation). Similarly, someone like John Nash, the M.I.T and Princeton professor portrayed in “A Beautiful Mind,” might have a very strong sensory experience as if he or she is in the presence of another person and, nevertheless, not judge that he or she is in the presence of another person. Rather, such a person might judge that he or she is alone and that the sensory experience is a hallucination. Thus, critics conclude, even if people cannot control the information provided to them by their senses, they can control whether they believe (so to speak) “what their senses tell them.” Second, they contend that like Williams’ original version of the argument, Pojman’s revised version would demonstrate, at best, that it is impossible for people to will to believe some propositions. Thus, they conclude that it does not demonstrate that direct doxastic voluntarism is false, let alone conceptually impossible.

iii. The Intentional Acts Argument

Dion Scott-Kakures (1994) offers another kind of argument that attempts to show that direct doxastic voluntarism is conceptually impossible. The argument uses an analysis of the nature of intentional acts to suggest that direct doxastic voluntarism is impossible. It goes as follows. If direct doxastic voluntarism is true, then believing is an act that is under people’s direct voluntary control. Moreover, any act that is under a person’s direct voluntary control is guided and monitored by an intention. For instance, steering one’s car through a left turn signal is an act that is under one’s direct voluntary control, and it is an act that is guided and monitored by one’s intention to turn left. Acquiring a belief, however, is different. It is, by its very nature, not the kind of act that can be guided and monitored by an intention. Thus, acquiring a belief is not under a person’s direct voluntary control. Therefore, direct doxastic voluntarism is conceptually impossible.

The critical premise in the argument is the claim that acquiring a belief is, by its very nature, not the kind of act that can be guided and monitored by an intention. Why, though, should we think that that claim is true? Suppose someone wants to form a belief at will. Let’s take a particular case. Suppose Dave wants to will himself to believe that God exists. The problem, according to Scott-Kakures, is that Dave has a certain perspective on the world, which includes his other beliefs, his desires, etc., and that perspective is incompatible with Dave believing that God exists. Thus, so long as Dave maintains that perspective, he cannot form an intention that could succeed in guiding and monitoring an act of believing that God exists. This problem, however, is not unique to Dave. Any person who wants to will himself or herself to believe a proposition faces the same obstacle. The perspective the person has of the world will not allow him or her to form an intention that is compatible with the belief he or she wants to form. Therefore, as long as the person maintains that perspective, it is simply not possible for him or her to form an intention that could guide and monitor the act of willing himself or herself to believe. Hence, acquiring a belief is, by its very nature, not the kind of act that can be guided and monitored by an intention.

Critics, however, suggest that the perspective of a person who attempts to believe at will might be compatible with the proposition he or she attempts to believe (Radcliffe 1997). They argue as follows. Consider Dave’s case. Because of his isolated background, he may be ignorant both of the standard arguments for and of the standard arguments against the existence of God. Nonetheless, he might understand the proposition God exists and desire to believe it for pragmatic purposes. For instance, reading Pascal’s Pensées may have persuaded him that the potential benefits of believing that God exists outweigh the potential detriments of not believing that God exists. From this perspective, he might form the intention to acquire at will the belief that God exists; however, nothing in the perspective that generates his intention is incompatible with believing that God exists. Hence, the perspective from which Dave generates his intention to believe that God exists is not necessarily incompatible with believing that God exists. Moreover, Dave’s case is not unique. Other people can find themselves in similar circumstances. Thus, at the moment a person attempts to acquire a belief at will, his or her perspective might be compatible with the proposition he or she wants to believe. Hence, the critics conclude, Scott-Kakures’s argument fails to show that direct doxastic voluntarism is conceptually impossible.

iv. The Contingent Inability Argument

Some philosophers, such as Edwin Curley, contend that regardless of whether direct doxastic voluntarism is conceptually impossible, it is false. Curley, specifically, argues as follows (1975, 178). If direct doxastic voluntarism is true, then people should be able to believe at will at least those propositions for which the evidence is not compelling. Let us test the doctrine empirically. Consider the recent meteorological conditions on Jupiter. We do not have compelling evidence either confirming or disconfirming the proposition it rained three hours ago on Jupiter, so it is a proposition about which we ought to be able to form a belief at will. Curley, however, suggests that he cannot form a belief about the proposition and suggests that his readers cannot either, unless they have strikingly different minds than his. Thus, he suggests, there is at least one (and probably many other) clear counterexamples to the claim that people have direct voluntary control over their beliefs. Therefore, he suggests, regardless of whether direct doxastic voluntarism is conceptually impossible, it is false.

Critics could grant that the argument seems to succeed in showing that there are propositions with respect to which we stand, like Buridan’s Ass, unable to decide between our options—in this case, affirming or denying a proposition. They would contend, however, that the argument’s success is limited and that it shows, at most, that there are some propositions with respect to which people do not have direct voluntary control (cf. Ryan 2003, 62-7). Therefore, they would conclude, the argument does not show that direct doxastic voluntarism is false.

b. Arguments for Direct Doxastic Voluntarism

i. The Observed Ability Argument

According to Carl Ginet, there are a number of cases in which people can will to believe certain propositions, provided that their evidence regarding the propositions is inconclusive (2001, 64-5; cf. Ryan 2003, 62-7). He offers a number of examples. Let us consider two. The first involves a person deciding to believe a proposition so that she can stop worrying. The scenario is as follows:

Before Sam left for his office this morning, Sue asked him to bring from his office a particular book that she needs to use for preparing her lecture the next day, on his way back home.. Later Sue wonders whether Sam will remember to bring the book. She recalls that he has sometimes, though not often, forgotten such things. But, given the thought that her continuing to wonder whether he’ll remember to bring the book will make her anxious all day, she decides to stop fretting and decides to believe that he will remember to bring the book she wanted.

The second involves a road trip taken by Ginet and his wife. He says,

We have started on a trip by car, and 50 miles from home my wife asks me if I locked the front door. I seem to remember that I did, but I don’t have a clear, detailed, confident memory impression of locking that door (and I am aware that my unclear, unconfident memory impressions have sometimes been mistaken). But, given the great inconvenience of turning back to make sure the undesirability of worrying about it while continuing on, I decide to continue on and believe that I did lock it.

According to Ginet, a person decides to believe a proposition when he or she stakes something on the truth of the proposition, where to “stake something” on the truth of a proposition is understood as follows:

In deciding to perform an action, a person staked something on its being that case that a certain proposition, p, was true if and only if when deciding to perform the action, the person believed that performing the action was (all things considered) at least as good as other options open to him or her if and only if the proposition, p, was true.

Thus, on Ginet’s account, in deciding not to remind Sam to bring the book she needed, Sue staked something on the truth of the proposition Sam will bring the book and, hence, decided to believe that Sam would bring it. If Sue had decided to remind Sam to bring the book she needed, Sue would have staked something on the truth of the proposition Sam will not bring the book and, hence, decided to believe that Sam would not bring it. Thus, on Ginet’s account, Sue could have decided to believe that Sam will bring the book or that Sam will not bring the book. Similarly, in deciding to continue on his road trip without worrying, Ginet staked something on the truth of the proposition I locked the door and, hence, decided to believe that he locked the door. If Ginet had decided to pull off the road to call and ask his neighbor to check Ginet’s front door, then Ginet would have staked something on the truth of the proposition I did not lock the door and, hence, decided to believe that he did not lock the door. Thus, on Ginet’s account, he could have decided to believe that he did lock the door or that he did not lock the door. Therefore, direct doxastic voluntarism is a thesis that describes an observed ability that people have.

Ginet surely seems correct in noting that people have experiences in which they are (at least moderately) anxious about the truth of some proposition, when the evidence they have for the proposition is ambiguous, and they alleviate their anxiety by electing to act as if the proposition is true (or false). Thus, to rebut Ginet’s argument, critics would have to show that what people do in such cases is not decide to believe. But how else such cases can be described? If such people are not deciding to believe, then what are they deciding to do? A quick survey of the philosophical literature on the nature of belief suggests two possible lines of reply. First, someone might be able to rebut Ginet’s argument by showing that that the kind of cases to which Ginet refers are cases not of believing a proposition, but of accepting a proposition. According to this line of rebuttal, the person understands the proposition and decides to act as if the proposition is true for some practical purpose, but (unlike in cases of believing) the person neither affirms nor denies the proposition (see, for example, Buckareff 2004; cf. Bratman 1999; Cohen 1989, 1992). Second, someone might be able to rebut Ginet’s argument by showing that the kind of cases to which he refers are cases not of believing a proposition, but of acting as if a proposition is true (see, for example, Alston 1989, 122-7; cf. Steup 2000). According to this second line of rebuttal, the person decides to act as if the proposition is true for some practical purpose(s), regardless of whether the person understands the proposition, and of whether he or she affirms, denies, or suspends judgment about the proposition. (For a related discussion of another of Ginet’s cases, see Nottelmann 2006.)

i. The Action Analogy Argument

James Montmarquet offers the following, analogical argument for direct doxastic voluntarism (1986, 49). “[R]easons for action play a role in the determination of action which is analogous to the role played by reasons for thinking-true in the determination of beliefs.” Hence, if the controlling influence of reasons on actions is compatible with the voluntariness of the action, the same is true with respect to the influence of reasons for thinking-true on beliefs. The controlling influence of reasons on actions is compatible with the voluntariness of action. Therefore, the controlling influence of reasons on beliefs is compatible with the voluntariness of belief. Hence, direct doxastic voluntarism is no more problematic than voluntarism about people’s other actions, and since we regard voluntarism as true with respect to people’s other actions, we should also regard direct doxastic voluntarism as true. (For discussions of related arguments, see, for example, Nottelmann 2006, Ryan 2003, Steup 2000.)

Granting that the inferences are warranted, there are two lines of objection open for a possible rebuttal. First, one might be able to rebut the argument by showing that there is a significant difference between the role that reasons play in determining action and the role that reasons play in determining beliefs. For instance, one could undermine Montmarquet’s argument if one could show that there is a problem with the analogy on which it depends: the controlling influence of reasons on acting is to the voluntariness of acting as the controlling influence of reasons on believing is to the voluntariness of believing. What, though, is wrong with that analogy? One possibility is that the controlling influence of reasons on people’s actions is often resistible in a way that the controlling influence of reasons on people’s beliefs is not. For example, it seems to make sense that a person would say, “I have overwhelming evidence that I should not smoke, but I still smoke.” Does it make sense, however, for a person to say, similarly, that she has overwhelming evidence that a proposition is false but that she believes it is true? Some would answer negatively, pointing to claims like, “I have overwhelming evidence that lead does not float in water, but I still believe that it does.” Others would answer affirmatively, pointing to claims like, “I have overwhelming evidence that my son has been killed in action in the war—for example, he has been M.I.A. for years, the rescue team recovered his bloody uniform—nonetheless, I still believe that he is alive” (cf. Meiland 1980). The challenge for those who take this first strategy in attempting to undermine Montmarquet’s argument is to show that the cases of those who answer affirmatively are not cases of choosing to believe, but cases of something else—for example, accepting that a proposition is true or acting as if a proposition is true (cf. Bratman 1999; Cohen 1989, 1992, as well as Alston 1989, 122-7, Buckareff 2004).

Second, one might be able to rebut the argument by showing that the controlling influence of reasons on actions is incompatible with the voluntariness of actions. For instance, one could undermine Montmarquet’s argument if one could show that as the influence of people’s reasons on their actions become stronger, their performance of the actions becomes less voluntary. Why, though, might we think that the influence of reasons on people’s actions would have this effect? One type of possibility includes cases of coercion (cf. Aquinas, Summa Theologicae, I-II, Q. 6, aa. 6-7). Suppose a person gave her money to a mugger who threatened her with a loaded gun, yelling, “Your money or your life!” Did she give the money voluntarily? Some would argue that she did not. At this point, the debate becomes rather subtle. On the one hand, she did choose (that is, she did ‘will’) to perform the action. On the other hand, her act of willing seems to lack the requisite freedom such that we would say she had direct voluntary control over that act in the way that we would say, for instance, that she had direct voluntary control over her act of writing a check to charity earlier that morning. Thus, a second strategy for undermining Montmarquet’s argument requires one both (i) to show that there are cases of acting with respect to which people lack direct voluntary control and (ii) to demonstrate why cases of believing are like such cases of acting.

4. Significance: Ethical, Epistemological, Political, and Religious

The issue of doxastic voluntarism has three particularly significant philosophical implications. The first concerns an issue at the intersection of ethics and epistemology: specifically, the possibility of an ethics of belief. The second concerns political philosophy: specifically, the extent of intellectual (and especially religious) freedom. The third concerns philosophy of religion: specifically, the doctrine of hell.

Each relies on a certain moral principle. Call it the Blameworthiness Principle:

People are morally blameworthy only for those actions they perform (or for those dispositions they acquire) voluntarily.

Proponents suggest that the truth of this principle is intuitively evident in light of commonsense examples. For instance, proponents contend, we can hold people morally blameworthy for acts like murder or dispositions like being cruel only if they killed an innocent person or developed the disposition to be cruel voluntarily. If a person committed murder or developed a disposition to be cruel because he or she was under the control of an evil demon, or a nefarious neurosurgeon, or some other such manipulative agent, we would blame the manipulative agent, not the person who committed the act or caused the development of the disposition. We would do so, proponents argue, because we recognize, intuitively, the truth of the Blameworthiness Principle.

In light of this principle, some philosophers argue, as follows, that an ethics of belief is untenable (see, for example, Price 1954, especially, p. 11; for a related debate, see, for example, Chisholm 1968, 1991, Firth 1998a, 1998b, Haack 2001). Direct doxastic voluntarism is false: people do not have direct voluntary control over their beliefs. Moreover, since the Blameworthiness Principle is true, people are not morally blameworthy for their beliefs. Thus, although we might hold people morally responsible for being intellectually lazy or intellectually cowardly (for example, by failing to gather evidence or by failing to consider evidence), there is no such thing as an ethics of belief per se—that is, an ethical evaluation of a person for judging that a particular proposition is true (or false).

Some political philosophers have traditionally utilized the preceding type of argument against the possibility of an ethics of belief in their arguments for toleration (see, for example, Bayle 2005; Locke 1983; Mill 1974; Spinoza 2001). The general line of thought is as follows. People can control whether they conduct an inquiry and whether they evaluate a body of evidence, so they are certainly responsible for inquiring and examining evidence. However, since the Blameworthiness Principle is true and since believing (or, more specifically, judging) is not the sort of thing over which people have voluntary control, if people examine a body of evidence in good conscience and form a belief regarding a proposition, the state has no right to punish them for holding that belief. Thus, for instance, although the state may demand that people hear the evidence for a particular religion, it has no right to punish people for failing to believe the tenets of that religion.

Some philosophers of religion have suggested that the same kind of argument applies to questions of justice not only regarding human affairs, but also regarding divine affairs. For example, they contend that it follows from the falsity of direct doxastic voluntarism and the truth of the Blameworthiness Principle that not even God could punish people, in this life or in the next, for failing to believe the tenets of a certain religion. Thus, they contend that a just God could not torment people eternally in hell, for failing to believe the tenets of a certain religion. Those who wish to deny this line of argument seem compelled to choose among the following strategies. First, they could attempt to show that direct doxastic voluntarism is true. Second, they could attempt to demonstrate that the Blameworthiness Principle is false. Third, they could attempt to show that God holds people accountable not for failing to form certain judgments about a particular set of religious principles, but for some other fault(s)—for example, failing to conduct an adequate investigation into or failing to be open to the truth of the tenets of a certain religion.

5. Conclusion

Thus, the debate about doxastic voluntarism is particularly intriguing and important for two reasons. First, it requires us to form a deeper understanding about vital aspects of human nature. For instance, it entails that we do further research in philosophy of mind, action theory, and moral psychology so that we can understand both the nature of belief and the nature of the will, or (more specifically) the nature of voluntary control. Second, the outcome of the debate has direct and significant practical implications for our understanding of the scope of ethical and of epistemic obligations, our understanding of the relationship between personal rights and state responsibility, and our understanding both of the nature of God and of divine justice.

6. References and Further Reading

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  • Buckareff, Andrei A. “Doxastic Decisions and Controlling Belief.” Acta Analytica 21 (2006): 102-14.
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Author Information

Rico Vitz
Email: rico.vitz@unf.edu
University of North Florida
U. S. A.

William Edward Burghardt Du Bois (1868—1963)

W. E. B. Du Bois was an important American thinker: a poet, philosopher, economic historian, sociologist, and social critic. His work resists easy classification. This article focuses exclusively on Du Bois’ contribution to philosophy; but the reader must keep in mind throughout that Du Bois is more than a philosopher; he is, for many, a great social leader. His extensive efforts all bend toward a common goal, the equality of colored people. His philosophy is significant today because it addresses what many would argue is the real world problem of white domination. So long as racist white privilege exists, and suppresses the dreams and the freedoms of human beings, so long will Du Bois be relevant as a thinker, for he, more than almost any other, employed thought in the service of exposing this privilege, and worked to eliminate it in the service of a greater humanity. Du Bois’ pragmatist philosophy, as well as his other work, underlies and supports this larger social aim. Later in life, Du Bois turned to communism as the means to achieve equality. He envisioned communism as a society that promoted the well being of all its members, not simply a few. Du Bois came to believe that the economic condition of Africans and African-Americans was one of the primary modes of their oppression, and that a more equitable distribution of wealth, as advanced by Marx, was the remedy for the situation.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Work
  2. General Philosophical Orientation
  3. Double Consciousness
  4. Second Sight
  5. Critique of White Imperialism
  6. Later Marxism
  7. Du Bois’ Significance Today
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Du Bois was born in Great Barrington, Massachusetts, on February 23, 1868. He had a happy early childhood, largely unaware of race prejudice, until one day, as he records in Souls of Black Folk, a student in his class refused to exchange greeting cards with him simply because he was black (Souls, 2). This experience made Du Bois feel for the first time that he was different, in that he was both inside the white world (since he lived within it) and outside of it (since he was perceived in the white world through the lens of race prejudice). Throughout his life after this event, Du Bois was continually made to feel, as he says, that he was both an American and an African, but never an African-American, with his own distinct, coherent identity in the American world. “One ever feels his two-ness,” he explains (Souls, 2).

Du Bois refused to become depressed by his new realization, and in fact made it his life’s work to combat race prejudice and to find a way to achieve coherent personhood for blacks in America. Du Bois, it turns out, was just the right person for the job, since he had it in his character to affirm himself as a matter of course. He was a bold, courageous youth, willing to fight for himself and his peers. All his life Du Bois was self-assertive without being aggressive, assuming without hesitation the right to equality of all people.

Knowing his mission early on, Du Bois headed to school to become educated adequately to realize it (a task not without struggle in the virulently racist world of the times). He attended Fisk University as an undergraduate student and Harvard University as a graduate student as well as studied abroad in Germany. He was the first African-American to be awarded a Ph.D. from Harvard. At Harvard, he studied philosophy under William James, George Santayana, and Josiah Royce. Du Bois learned a lot from his philosophy teachers, especially James, but he came to reject academic philosophy, referring to it as “lovely but sterile” (Lewis, Biography 92). He turned to history and sociology instead.

Du Bois’ dissertation reflects this new direction. It is entitled The Suppression of the African Slave Trade to the United States of America, 1638-1870. Du Bois began to turn his energies to a socio-economic analysis of the African-American situation. His efforts were guided by the belief that a proper understanding of this situation would help eliminate racism; if people only understood properly what African-Americans were going through, Du Bois felt, they would appreciate better the circumstances that they face and would work toward their full liberation and flourishing. This line of thought led to the publication of The Philadelphia Negro in 1899.

Du Bois’ most important work, The Souls of Black Folk, was published in 1903, and reflects an important new direction of his thinking. This is the work for which he is most renowned, the work in which he declared, famously, that “the problem of the Twentieth Century is the problem of the color-line” (Souls, V). About this work, Du Bois’ biographer writes, “It was one of those events epochally dividing history into a before and an after” (Lewis, Biography 277). What makes this work so important, culturally, is the way in which it speaks out passionately and uncompromisingly about the spirit of African-Americans, emphasizing their humanity and strength despite centuries of the worst oppression. In addition, Du Bois in this book dared to challenge the most famous African-American intellectual of the day, Booker T. Washington, and to assert an opposing principle to Washington’s belief that industrial education alone would lead to equality. Du Bois argued instead that African-Americans must be given the chance to attain the most sophisticated, higher education as well, so that they might partake of the goods of civilization as well as be fit candidates to educate other African-Americans in turn (a task not to be left fully to whites).

The Souls of Black Folk is a work rich in philosophical content, as will be discussed in more detail below. For now, however, it should be noted that Du Bois shifts direction in this work and takes a novel approach from his previous work. Still trying to build understanding and sympathy for the situation of African-Americans, especially in the period after Reconstruction, Du Bois now combines socio-economic research with poetry, song, story, and philosophy. A new, multi-faceted voice grips Du Bois, allowing him, in what can only be called a great and profound piece of literature, to pierce the mind of his readers and to make them feel overwhelmingly the significance of being black in America.

In his middle works, most notably Darkwater, published in 1919, Du Bois changes directions again, as Manning Marable notes (Marable, vi). This time, instead of trying to make the reader gently understand, Du Bois lambastes the reader for failing to understand. Darkwater is a fiery, accosting work, in which Du Bois makes such claims as that “white Christianity is a miserable failure” because of its racism (Darkwater, 21), and that white civilization is to a large extent “mutilation and rape masquerading as culture” (Darkwater, 21). Du Bois’ new approach consists of the attempt to wake up the reader from their racist slumber, to force them to see the racism wherever it is for what it is.

This work, in which Du Bois asserts that, “a belief in humanity is a belief in colored men” (Darkwater, 27), has become particularly important for later, critical race theory (see below). It is worth noting about the work for now that again Du Bois blends philosophy, poetry, literature, history, and sociology in a unique, energizing manner that was to remain his stylistic trademark.

Du Bois’ later works include Dusk of Dawn (1940), his “autobiography of a concept of race.” It also includes Black Folk, Then and Now: An Essay in the History and Sociology of the Negro Race (1939), in which he endorses a form of Marxist critique, and the posthumously published Autobiography of W. E. B. Du Bois (1968), which contains reflections on his life in its last decade.

Throughout his life, in addition to writing, Du Bois worked as an activist for social causes. He was editor of the journal, Crisis (1910-1919), which explored contemporary racial problems and how to combat them. He helped found the National Association for the Advancement of Colored People (NAACP) as well as the Pan African Congress. He ran for the U.S. Senate in order to help improve the plight of African Americans. Later in life, as the chair of the Peace Information Center, he called for banishing atomic weapons and making them illegal (Lewis; Hynes).

In 1959, after a lifetime of combating rampant racism in the U.S., Du Bois had enough and expatriated to Ghana, Africa. He spent his time in Africa working on an Encyclopedia of African Peoples and refining his social analysis, which had come to include Marxist elements (he became an official member of the U.S. Communist Party before his departure). Du Bois died in Accra, Ghana, on August 27, 1963—immediately before the March on Washington that inaugurated the civil rights movement in America, as several commentators have observed (Lewis; Hynes).

2. General Philosophical Orientation

Philosophically speaking, Du Bois’ work is difficult to characterize, since he lived and wrote for such a long time and refined his position over so many years. Eugene C. Holmes has described Du Bois as a materialist and a social philosopher (Holmes, 80-1). According to Holmes, “with Dr. Du Bois…it was always the problem of getting the truth about race by means of a scientific approach” (Holmes, 77).

Recent scholarship has adopted a more nuanced perspective. Cornel West puts Du Bois decidedly in the camp of the pragmatists, that is, in the camp of someone who works in the “Emersonian tradition” of evading traditional philosophical problems altogether and turning instead to the empowerment of individuals and communities. What Du Bois adds to the pragmatists, according to West, is an impassioned and focused concern for “the wretched of the earth” and for thinking about how one can alleviate their plight (West, 138). Other more recent approaches tend to see Du Bois as a highly important critical theorist, or someone whose work is inherently and purposefully interdisciplinary in nature, drawing on multiple disciplines as needed to critique power, especially white power (Rabaka, 2). This view would seemed to be confirmed by Du Bois’ biographer, who concludes his painstakingly thorough account of Du Bois’ life and work by noting that Du Bois, in essence, “attempted virtually every possible solution to the problem of twentieth century racism—scholarship, propaganda…international communism” (Lewis, The Fight for Equality, 571). Hence, the traditional view of Du Bois as always concerned with getting at the truth about race through science would seem to be contradicted by recent scholarship, which holds that Du Bois tried multiple, irreconcilable approaches (even propaganda) to achieve his ends.

Even so, there remains important recent scholarship that sees Du Bois as a more traditional philosopher, concerned with the ideals of truth, goodness, and beauty. According to Keith Byerman, for example, Du Bois possesses “confidence in his grasp of truth,” and his autobiographies, for one, are stories in which he always gains “a fuller view of truth” (Byerman, 7). The truth that Du Bois realizes, according to Byerman, is that there is a “Law of the Father,” which “challenges the corrupt father… By supplanting the father, the son can install an “empire” of reason, morality, and beauty to replace arbitrary power and self-interest” (Byerman, 7-8). On this reading, which is Platonic in many ways, truth, goodness, and beauty are ideal qualities by appeal to which Du Bois judges and condemns the corrupt world of racial inequality.

Overall, then, we can see that the general interpretation of Du Bois’ philosophy is contested ground, and that no clear-cut, agreed-upon definition of it emerges from the scholarship. Some Continental Philosophers have even identified Du Bois as Hegelian in a crucial respect (or at least as having “held out as ideal” one of Hegel’s main goals) (Higgins, 58). The point is made that, like Hegel, the Du Boisian self is also torn asunder, divided within itself, only to have to struggle to attain a higher synthesis of identity in a new formation. Materialist, Pragmatist, Critical Theorist, Platonist, Hegelian—Du Bois’ general philosophical orientation is far from having been finally determined.

3. Double Consciousness

Whatever turns out to be the best general account of Du Bois’ philosophy, it seems the significance of his thought only really shows up in the specific details of his works themselves, especially in The Souls of Black Folk. It is here that he first develops his central philosophical concept, the concept of double consciousness, and spells out its full implications.

The aim of Souls of Black Folk is to show the spirit of black people in the United States: to show their humanity and the predicament that has confronted their humanity. Du Bois asserts that “the color line” divides people in the States, causes massive harm to its inhabitants, and ruins its own pretensions to democracy. He shows, in particular, how a veil has come to be put over African-Americans, so that others do not see them as they are; African-Americans are obscured in America; they cannot be seen clearly, but only through the lens of race prejudice. African-Americans feel this alien perception upon them but at the same time feel themselves as themselves, as their own with their own legitimate feelings and traditions. This dual self-perception is known as “double consciousness.” Du Bois’ aim in Souls is to explain this concept in more specific detail and to show how it adversely affects African-Americans. In the background of Souls is always also the moral import of its message, to the effect that the insertion of a veil on human beings is wrong and must be condemned on the grounds that it divides what otherwise would be a unique and coherent identity. Souls thus aims to make the reader understand, in effect, that African-Americans have a distinct cultural identity, one that must be acknowledged, respected, and enabled to flourish.

Souls contains a Forethought, fourteen chapters, and an Afterthought. Each chapter is preceded by a bar of African-American spiritual music coupled with a poem.

The Forethought tells us the plan of the work: to present “the spiritual world in which ten thousand Americans live and strive” (Souls, v). Chapter 1, “Of Our Spiritual Strivings,” is perhaps the most important chapter of the book from a strictly philosophical perspective. Here Du Bois lays out the basic concept of double consciousness, while the remainder of the work provides concrete instances of the concept. The Afterthought, rich and powerful in poetic imagery, implores the reader not to let Du Bois’ “leaves” fail to take root: it is an impassioned call to action based on the book’s insights.

“An American, a Negro; two souls, two thoughts, two unreconciled strivings”—with these words from Chapter 1, Du Bois highlights the extreme tension involved in double consciousness (Souls, 2). Or, as he also expresses the point, “Why did God make me an outcast and a stranger in mine own house?” (Souls, 2). Double consciousness is the awareness of being a split person, a dual self whose different parts are at dire odds with one another. The American self in a person, such as America was then constituted, works against the Negro self; while the Negro self, resisting as it must such a constitution, works against the American self. In one person, therefore, we have two deeply divided tendencies.

Du Bois does not conceive this division to be a good thing; he conceives it, indeed, as positively unhealthy and problematic. He refers to it as “this waste of double aims, this seeking to satisfy two unreconciled ideals,” which “has wrought sad havoc with the courage and faith and deeds of ten thousand people” (Souls, 3). Not knowing which particular direction to turn, always fighting against oneself in either direction, what double consciousness prevents is the attainment of “self-conscious manhood,” a coherent sense of self and direction, the ability “to merge his double self into a better and truer self” (Souls, 2).

In Du Bois’ conception, the human self is thus capable of being cut or split, and at the same time capable of growing back together again and becoming, as he says, better and even more true. Of course, a truer self implies something like truth—and thus we can see that Du Bois holds to the idea of a more genuine ideal of a person, specifically of African-Americans. Du Bois’ idea is that African-Americans have in truth a unique, valuable identity but that current conditions keep this identity from forming or at least becoming fully active and available. We can see here, too, Du Bois’ famous call for allowing African-Americans to become genuine participants in American culture, “to be a co-worker in the kingdom of culture” (Souls, 3), in such a way that American culture could only benefit by the inclusion of its own genuine members. Du Bois does not wish to eliminate white American culture nor Negro culture in America. He wishes to fuse the two into a genuine new element, “in order that some day on American soil two world-races may give each to each those characteristics both so sadly lack” (Souls, 7). Through recognition of a place for African-Americans in American culture, Du Bois wishes to achieve a genuine American culture as well: “the ideal of human brotherhood, gained through the unifying ideal of Race” (Souls, 7).

In the remaining chapters of Souls, Du Bois provides some rather powerful (and tragic) instances of the struggles with dual selfhood that African-Americans have had to undergo. A key idea of Chapter 1 is to show what Reconstruction meant for African-Americans: the chance not only to be free, and educated, and to have the vote, but more importantly (as Du Bois argues it) to become whole human beings. Chapter 2 examines the aftermath of Reconstruction and shows how Reconstruction (in the form of the Freedmen’s Bureau) at first worked slowly toward, but then ultimately failed to achieve, this ideal. Chapter 3 continues to show how the ideal failed to develop by pointing to the slow and ineffective rise of leadership of African-Americans. It is in this chapter that Du Bois famously challenges Booker T. Washington for his call to lead blacks through industrial education without the inclusion of higher learning. How, Du Bois reasons, can African-Americans become “co-workers in the kingdom of culture” if they are only trained in the sterile practice of moneymaking? In Chapters 4 and 5, Du Bois takes his readers further into the idea of the veil, taking a look both inside it and outside in each chapter, respectively. By Chapter 6, we realize that the main problem in achieving coherent personhood for African-Americans is education. Chapters 7 and 8 outline the struggles that the masses of African-American workers, in particular, have undergone. Chapter 9 turns toward the present relations between African-Americans and white Americans. It focuses, in particular, on the manners and modes of segregation that keep the best of whites living apart from the best of African-Americans, thereby preventing a fruitful fusion of cultures. In Chapter 10, Du Bois purports to lift the veil, so that whites can see inside and especially appreciate the religious sense and striving of African Americans. He shows that the meaning of the religion is that it constitutes a special place where the kind of community and life for African-Americans can be attained that the white world denies them. Religion has had to become a refuge, but also at the same time a source of genuine freedom of expression and creativity. Chapter 11, which is very moving, recounts the birth (and loss) of Du Bois’ own son as an instance of his own struggle against white culture. Here Du Bois laments that his newborn, innocent son will soon have to cross into the color line of hateful American prejudice. Chapters 12 and 13 discuss the struggles that great African-American souls had to deal with to become more fully appreciated, including a narrative about a man named John who defended his sister against dishonor only to be met with horrible racism as a result. Chapter 14, the last chapter, closes with a rich discussion of African-American music in which Du Bois points to this music as an emblem of the possible brighter future in which African-Americans become co-workers in American culture. Such music is the symbol of this better future in which African-Americans contribute to the culture since it is, after all, he claims, the only genuinely beautiful music that has come out of America to date, and reveals what African-Americans can accomplish.

Thus, Du Bois provides us with multiple instances of double consciousness. In each case, African-Americans are shown to be struggling to achieve themselves, due to the enforced divisions and roadblocks of white culture. What Du Bois presents here are short, powerful looks at the struggle to be recognized as fully human, a struggle due to the horrible crime of racism. The concept of double consciousness plays itself out in a variety of ways—from the agonizing worry a father feels in raising his son in a white world to the failed policies of segregation and the creation of ghettos in American cities—always with the same devastating effect, the compromising of identity, and yet with a new identity that is forming and emerging. The African-American is forced to struggle to be him- or herself in America, Du Bois shows, but they have done so heroically and with deep humanity throughout their plight.

Some Du Bois interpreters (Higgins) have found parallels between Du Bois’ conception of double consciousness and Nietzsche’s conception of the free spirit, or the man who stands apart. The idea is that in both cases someone within the culture is at the same time able to stand outside of it. But as we have seen above, beyond this general notion, Du Bois clearly develops his concept of double consciousness in the context of African-Americans specifically. Nor does he favor this sense of division in the way that Nietzsche sometimes seems to do but rather he actively seeks to overcome it.

The overall implication of Souls is that such enforced separation of consciousness as occurs in the case of African-Americans is wrong; it violates something fundamental about the human condition, and it ruins our republic, by preventing us from forming the best use of our talents by drawing on the strengths of all races. We must work together to attain a greater sense of personhood for the members of our culture.

4. Second Sight

Du Bois’ other major philosophical concept is that of “second sight.” This is a concept he develops most precisely in Darkwater, a work, as we have seen, in which Du Bois changes his approach and takes up a stauncher stance against white culture.

Du Bois holds that due to their double consciousness, African-Americans possess a privileged epistemological perspective. Both inside the white world and outside of it, African-Americans are able to understand the white world, while yet perceiving it from a different perspective, namely that of an outsider as well.

The white person in America, by contrast, contains but a single consciousness and perspective, for he or she is a member of a dominant culture, with its own racial and cultural norms asserted as absolute. The white person looks out from themselves and sees only their own world reflected back upon them—a kind of blindness or singular sight possesses them. Luckily, as Du Bois makes clear, the dual perspective of African-Americans can be used to grasp the essence of whiteness and to expose it, in the multiple senses of the word “expose.” That is to say, second sight allows an African-American to bring the white view out into the open, to lay it bare, and to let it wither for the problematic and wrong-headed concept that it is. The destruction of “whiteness” in this way leaves whites open to the experience of African-Americans, as a privileged perspective, and hence it also leaves African-Americans with a breach in the culture through which they could enter with their legitimate, and legitimating, perspectives.

5. Critique of White Imperialism

In a particularly important essay of Dark Water, called “The Souls of White Folk,” Du Bois reveals some of the wisdom of his race’s privileged perspective. As Du Bois sees it, whites see themselves a certain way, namely as superior, civilized, perfect, beneficent, and called upon to help other peoples with their higher wisdom. But, in truth, as African-Americans can perceive quite plainly, whites are actually imperialistic, ugly, greedy, and corrupt in their practices. Whites are imprisoned in their own false self-conception. Their own seriousness with themselves contrasts sharply with the reality that African-Americans see. What they see, above all, is that white society consists not of higher wisdom but only of “mutilation and rape masquerading as culture” (Darkwater, 21).

Du Bois makes his claims more pointed and specific by noting that the concept of “whiteness” is what we might today call a social construct. It is a concept that developed in the late nineteenth century and in the twentieth century. Before that, various societies hardly made much of differences in skin color. What is significant about this fact is that it shows whiteness as a category to emerge simultaneously with the development of industrialism and its counterpart colonialism. Western peoples wanted the material resources of the third world, and so they invented the myth of their own superiority based on skin color, and the supposed inferiority of dark peoples, in order to assist them in their desire to steal.

Based on such maneuvers as these, the third world was conquered, dark peoples were murdered, raped, and exploited, and white culture became rich. This wealth and power in turn gave whites a sense of superiority. But this sense of superiority is undone by the tragic-comic self-conception whites have of themselves as superior simply because they are white, when in fact they are bound to a false, invented self-conception based on color, one that only serves to assist in murder and exploitation. The supposedly civilized concept of “whiteness” in truth sinks into barbarism and insatiable world conquest.

And it is this, precisely, that whites cannot see about themselves, but must learn to see, if the problem of the twentieth century, the problem of the color line, is to be overcome and the races are to create together a greater and truer democracy.

6. Later Marxism

Later in life, Du Bois turned to communism as the means to achieve equality. As he put it in his autobiography, “I now state my conclusion frankly and clearly: I believe in communism. I mean by communism, a planned way of life in the production of wealth and work designed for building a state whose object is the highest welfare of its people and not merely the profit of a part” (Autobiography, 57). Du Bois came to believe that the economic condition of Africans and African-Americans was one of the primary modes of their oppression, and that a more equitable distribution of wealth, as advanced by Marx, was the remedy to the situation.

Du Bois was not simply a follower of Marx, however. He also added keen insights to the communist tradition himself. One of his contributions is his insistence that communism contains no explicit means of liberating Africans and African-Americans, but that it ought to focus its attentions here and work toward this end. “The darker races,” to use Du Bois’ language, amount to the majority of the world’s proletariat. Without their liberation and motive force in the production of communism, it cannot be achieved. In Black Folk, Then and Now, Du Bois writes: “the dark workers of Asia, Africa, the islands of the sea, and South and Central America…these are the one who are supporting a superstructure of wealth, luxury, and extravagance. It is the rise of these people that is the rise of the world” (Black Folk, 383).

A further contribution Du Bois makes is to show how Utopian politics such as communism is possible in the first place. Building on Engle’s claim that freedom lies in the acknowledgment of necessity, as Maynard Solomon argues (Solomon, “Introduction” 258), (because in grasping necessity we accurately perceive what areas of life are open to free action), Du Bois insists on the power of dreams. Admitting our bound nature (bound to our bellies, bound to material conditions), even stressing it, he nonetheless emphasizes our range of powers within these constraints. In a lecture called “The Nature of Intellectual Freedom” that he delivered to the Cultural and Scientific Conference for World Peace in 1949, using language that anticipates Jean-Paul Sartre, Du Bois calls attention to “the upsurging emotions,” the mind’s ability to go beyond what is present (259). Also like Sartre, Du Bois attempts to employ this power behalf of socialism. As Du Bois sees it, the human mind has the ability to take flight into “infinite freedoms” (“The Nature,” 259). This “upsurging” ability of mind is vital to bringing about socialism, for it allows us to dream of what life and social conditions might be as compared to what they currently are (Solomon, “Introduction,” 258). If properly cultivated, it allows us to see beyond the supposed necessity of the capitalist system, which everywhere presents itself, falsely, as the only way. Imagination surpasses untruth.

There is, as Du Bois points out (“The Nature,” 260), and Solomon confirms (Solomon, “Introduction,” 258), a “borderland” region in which compulsion and freedom meet. We must gain food, seek shelter, and raise our children. Necessity and liberty meet each other half way in this region, each pulling in their own direction, yet oftentimes working together. Our leaders take advantage of this region. They enforce necessity to work hard and to work in order to eat—in order, ultimately, to stifle individual freedom and its meanderings, its free decisions; and they promote ignorance of conditions in order to make us more beholden to them. However, there is hope in the fact that freedom also operates in this border region and that our minds can shape a part of what occurs in this region. Socialism must focus here and nurture this hope. It must promote, above all, “the dreaming of dreams by untwisted souls,” that our dreams might someday lead to better realities (“The Nature,” 260).

7. Du Bois’ Significance Today

Although difficult to characterize in general terms, Du Bois’ philosophy amounts to a programmatic shift away from abstraction and toward engaged, social criticism. In affecting this change in philosophy, especially on behalf of African-Americans and pertaining to the issue of race, Du Bois adds concrete significance and urgent application to American Pragmatism, as Cornel West maintains, a philosophy that is about social criticism, not about grasping absolute timeless truth.

Du Bois’ work has also been essential for Africana Critical Theory, and has influenced a host of thinkers in this tradition, as Rabaka has shown. Authors have often compared Du Bois’ work to that of Frantz Fanon in its call to overcome global race prejudice and to liberate Africa. In addition, Du Bois’ philosophy was a focus point for some of the work of Dr. Martin Luther King, Jr., among many other thinkers, who praised it highly for its commitment to truth about African-American experience and history (Rabaka, 35).

Du Bois’ philosophy has also contributed significantly to critical race theory, especially his article, “The Conservation of Races,” in which Du Bois argues, echoing Souls, that there is some real meaning to race, even if it is difficult precisely to define (Conservation, 84-85). As Robert Bernasconi makes clear, Du Bois is a central figure in the debate about the nature of race because he has triggered an intense discussion about the extent to which there is a biological basis to race and the extent to which social and cultural features define race as well (“Introduction,” 1-2).

With his concept of second sight, and the privileged perspective of minorities, Du Bois also anticipates, if not single handedly creates, Standpoint Theory in epistemology, which holds that minorities are better equipped to gain knowledge about the world than members of the dominant culture. Du Bois’ social philosophy also adds an important element to Marxism by focusing on the racial elements of oppression and their function in relation to class warfare. Moreover, his philosophy also anticipates certain French Feminists, such as Luce Irigaray, who demonstrate how culture mirrors back to us the image of our selves to the detriment of minorities.

Above all, however, Du Bois’ philosophy is significant today because it addresses what many would argue is the real world problem of white domination. So long as racist white privilege exists, and suppresses the dreams and the freedoms of human beings, so long will Du Bois be relevant as a thinker, for he, more than almost any other, employed thought in the service of exposing this privilege, and worked to eliminate it in the service of a greater humanity.

8. References and Further Reading

  • Bernasconi, Robert. “Introduction,” in Race, ed. Robert Bernasconi (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 2001).
  • Byerman, Keith E. Seizing the Word: History, Art, and Self in the Work of W. E. B. Du Bois (Athens: University of Georgia Press, 1994).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. Black Folk, Then and Now (Millwood, N.Y.: Kraus-Thomson Organization Limited, 1975).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. Darkwater: Voices From Within the Veil (Mineola, N. Y. Dover Publications, 1999).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. Dusk of Dawn: An Essay Toward an Autobiography of a Race Concept (New York: Schocken Books, 1968).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. The Autobiography of W. E. B. Du Bois: A Soliloquy on Viewing My Life from the Last Decade of its First Century (New York: International Publishers, 1980).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. “The Conservation of Races,” in Race, ed. Robert Bernasconi (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 2001).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. “The Nature of Intellectual Freedom,” in Solomon, Maynard, ed., Marxism and Art: Essays Classic and Contemporary (New York: Alfred A. Knopf, 1973).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. The Souls of Black Folk (New York: Dover Publications, 1994).
  • Du Bois, W. E. B. “The Talented Tenth.” 3/13/2006. <www.teachingamericanhistory.org/library/index.asp?documentprint=174>.
  • Harding, Sandra. The Feminist Standpoint Theory Reader: Intellectual and Political Controversies (London: Routledge, 2003).
  • Higgins, Kathleen. “Double Consciousness and Second Sight,” in Critical Affinities: Nietzsche and African American Thought, ed., Jacqueline Scott and A. Todd Franklin (Albany: State University of New York Press, 2006).
  • Holmes, Eugene C. “W. E. B. Du Bois: Philosopher,” in Black Titan: W. E. B. Du Bois (Boston: Beacon Press, 1970).
  • Hynes, Gerald C. “A Biographical Sketch of W. E. B. Du Bois.” 3/10/2006. http://www. Duboislc.org/html/DuBoisBio.html.
  • Irigaray, Luce. Speculum of the Other Woman. Trans. Gillian G. Gill (New York: Cornell University Press, 1974).
  • Lewis, David Levering. W. E. B. Du Bois: Biography of a Race: 1868-1919 (New York: Henry Holt, 1993).
  • Lewis, David Levering. W. E. B. Du Bois: The Fight for Equality and the American Century: 1919-1963 (New York: Henry Holt, 2000).
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Author Information

Donald J. Morse
Email: dmorse@webster.edu
Webster University
U. S. A.

Moral Egalitarianism

Egalitarianism is the position that equality is central to justice. It is a prominent trend in social and political philosophy and has also become relevant in moral philosophy (moral egalitarianism) since the late twentieth century. In social and political philosophy, the main focus of the debate is on two different trends, the Equality-of-What trend and the Why-Equality trend. The authors of the older, first trend focused on the main question, what the goods of distribution are (resources, equality of opportunity for welfare, and so forth) and according to which standard one should distribute the goods. The question, in the late twentieth century is, whether equality is the most or one of the most important part(s) of justice or whether it has no or nearly no importance for the nature of justice at all. Egalitarians believe that justice and equality are closely connected; prioritarians, instead, emphasise that the two concepts are unrelated. This article gives an overview of the main arguments and objections in the Why-Equality debate. These are the by-product objection of equality, the objection of inhumanity, the objection of complexity, the argument of the presumption of equality, and the argument for a pluralistic egalitarianism.

Table of Contents

  1. Preliminary Distinctions
  2. On some Difficulties within the Why-Equality Debate
  3. Objections to Moral Egalitarianism
    1. The By-Product Objection of Equality
    2. The Objection of Inhumanity
      1. The Fault is-Up-to-Them Objection
      2. The Objection of Stigmatizing
      3. The Tutelage Objection
    3. The Objection of Complexity
  4. Two Egalitarian Arguments
    1. The Egalitarians’ Assumption of the Presumption of Equality
    2. Pluralistic Egalitarianism
  5. Reference and Further Reading

1. Preliminary Distinctions

Egalitarianism is the position that equality is central to justice. It is a prominent trend in social and political philosophy and has also become relevant in moral philosophy (moral egalitarianism) since the late twentieth century. The very question is, whether equality is the most or one of the most important part(s) of justice or whether it has no or nearly no importance for the nature of justice at all (‘Why-Equality’). Egalitarians believe that justice and equality are closely connected; prioritarians, instead, emphasise that both concepts are not related.

Egalitarians think, firstly, that unfair life prospects should be equalized. Secondly, that equality is the most or one of the most important irreducible intrinsic or constitutive worth(s) of justice. Thirdly, that welfare should be increased. Fourthly, that justice is comparative. Fifthly, that inequalities are just when otherwise advantages are destroyed in the name of justice. Lastly, that there are certain absolute humanitarian principles like autonomy, freedom or human dignity.

Prioritarians think, firstly, that equality itself cannot be a foundation of justice and that it is no important irreducible aim of justice, it has no intrinsic moral worth (Frankfurt 1997) and it has no or at least no fundamental importance with regard to the justification of justice, it is rather a by-product, although it has some importance as reducible worth (Raz 1986). Secondly, the fulfilment of absolute standards like human dignity, respect, or citizenship are of utmost importance to give people the opportunity to live a human being-worthy life and not a life in miserable circumstances (Walzer 1983; Raz 1986; Frankfurt 1997; Parfit 1998; Anderson 1999). Thirdly, people should have access to food and shelter, basic medical supply, or should have private and political autonomy, and so forth. Fourthly, equality has some importance (i) in being a by-product, or (ii) in being one part among other parts as a comparative factor, (for example, in equality before the law, concerning equal chances, or with regard to the prohibition of discrimination), or (iii) in being a precondition for the fulfilment of certain absolute standards like political autonomy, social affiliation, and liberty of exchange (Krebs 2000, 2003).

2. On some Difficulties within the Why-Equality Debate

The main question, whether egalitarianism or prioritarianism has the most plausible conception of the relation between justice and equality, has not been successfully answered, yet. There had been attacks from both sides, which show that they did not attack the strongest but a weak version of the opponents’ view. A second mistake is the fact that the notions of justice and equality are also discussed – to a great extent – under the heading of questions of distributions, although this had been the main point of the ‘Equality-of-What’ debate, for example, ‘equality of resources’ (Rawls 1971, 1993; Dworkin 1981; Rakowski 1991; van Parijs 1995), ‘equality of opportunity for welfare’ (Arneson 1989; Cohen 1989; Roemer 1996, 1998), or ‘equality of capability to function’ (Sen 1992). This is a misleading focus, especially if one wants to determine the relation between these two important notions with regard to the question of justification. Questions of distributions are just one part of the story. Thirdly, the two most extreme assumptions (i) justice is equality and (ii) justice has nothing to do with equality are unsound, since common sense can easily show that these assumptions are out of sight right from the beginning. The interesting and more appropriated ones are situated right in-between. Equality should not be discussed in socioeconomic circumstances only, but also in the moral and political realm.

3. Objections to Moral Egalitarianism

The main objections against the egalitarians made by the prioritarians are, firstly, the by-product objection of equality (Raz 1986; Frankfurt 1987, 1997; Parfit 1998), secondly, the objection of inhumanity (Anderson 1999) and, thirdly, the objection of complexity (Walzer 1983).

a. The By-Product Objection of Equality

Firstly, the egalitarian view that equality is the central aim or one of the most important aims of justice and should not be seen as a mere by-product had been a mayor point of criticism on the prioritarian side (Raz 1986: 218-221, 227-229; Frankfurt 1987: 32-34 and 1997: 7 and 11; Parfit 1998: 13-15). They think that equality is a mere by-product and it is due to absolute standards like human dignity or respect, and so forth, whereas egalitarian equality is due to relational standards.

Prioritarians argue that in cases of people’s hunger and illness or deficiency of goods they should be helped because hunger, illness, and deficiency of goods are terrible circumstances for every human being and not because other people are in a better condition. The hunger and illness of other people or the deficiency of goods directly put us in the situation to help these people without making any comparison between them and those people who are better off. Frankfurt says that substantial – and not formal – definitions certainly have genuine moral importance and that it depends on human beings who live a good life and not on how their life is with regard to other human beings’ lives (Frankfurt 1997: 6). It seems that prioritarians think that egalitarians worship equality for the sake of equality only. In cases of illness, hunger and deficiency of goods the role of equality is not that simple as prioritarians want to make other people believe. Their objection loses its power, if one acknowledges that people in cases of illness, hunger or deficiency of goods should be treated equally as human beings if they get supply, that means there is no primarily discrimination ongoing. Equality has many faces and impartiality is one of it. There is room for proportional equality in cases of, for instance, deficiency of goods. This is no contradiction within the egalitarian view – proportional equality is part of equality. The idea that equality always means arithmetical equality is not justified.

The second example is Parfit’s ‘levelling down objection’ (Parfit 1998: chapter 4). Given that inequalities as such are bad, their disappearance would be, in one respect, a change to something, which is better. If, says Parfit, the better off people lose all their additional resources by a natural disaster and thus are in the same terrible situation than the other people, it will be something that teleological egalitarians may welcome, though some people lost all of their additional resources and nobody else could profit. Or, in the famous example given by Parfit: ‘Similarly, it would be in one way an improvement if we destroyed the eyes of the sighted, not to benefit the blind, but only to make the sighted blind. These implications can be more plausibly regarded as monstrous, or absurd.’ (Parfit 1998: chapter 4). Parfit knows that this would be not enough to criticize the egalitarians by using this objection, ‘it is not enough to claim that it would be wrong to produce equality by levelling down.’ Therefore he states: ‘Our objection must be that, if we achieve equality by levelling down, there is nothing good about what we have done. Similarly, if some natural disaster makes everyone equally badly off, that is not in any way good news.’ (Parfit 1998: chapter 4). It seems Parfit is thinking of an opponent who does everything for his worshipping of equality – that is, equality for the sake of equality. Plain egalitarians claim that inequalities are justified, if the only means to remove inequality would be to ‘level down’ the better off people to the standard of the badly off people, without any improvement with regard to the badly off people. The destruction of advantages in the name of justice is also unacceptable on the egalitarian view. There is a lot of rhetoric in this kind of objection. Parfit makes a distinction between the teleological and the deontic egalitarianism in this passage. And it is only the teleological egalitarianism, in Parfit’s view, that is open for criticism. The deontic egalitarian, unlike the teleological egalitarian, has no problem with the view that inequality itself is not bad in a way. But, says Parfit, ‘we may find it harder to justify some of our beliefs’ when adopting the deontic view. A sound egalitarianism should incorporate teleological and deontic aspects.

b. The Objection of Inhumanity

The objection of inhumanity, which had been brought into the discussion by Anderson (1999) is one of the main arguments against egalitarianism. Anderson’s version of the argument has three different parts, firstly, the ‘fault is-up-to-them’ objection (Anderson 1999: 295-302; also Barry 1991: 149 and MacLeod 1998: 75p.), secondly, the objection of stigmatizing (Anderson 1999: 302-307; also MacLeod 1998: 106-108), and thirdly, the tutelage objection (Anderson 1999: 310; also Hayek 1960: 85-102).

i. The Fault is-Up-to-Them Objection

The first part is an objection against the (supposed) egalitarian view that people who are responsible for their own terrible situation should be left alone with their problems, no matter what happens to them. The second part is an objection against the kind of reasons egalitarians have in order to help people who are in a terrible situation, which did not arise through their own fault. The third part is an objection against the decision-making of the state – in which category a misery should be placed – and the investigation of the citizens in order to get the relevant information for the state. This would be, in Anderson’s view, a case of putting the citizens under the tutelage of the state and harming their private sphere.

Proponents of luck egalitarianism want to equalize undeserved life prospects, the people should be responsible for their decisions, that means, strictly speaking, they have no justified demands for supply, if they get into a miserable situation on their own fault. Anderson criticises Rakowski’s view (1991), who states that it would be all right to let a guilty car driver die in a hospital, who has no insurance and illegally made a turn over on the street which causes a serious accident. The guilty car driver, so Rakowski, has no legal demands to be kept on the artificial respiration apparatus, any longer. Others argue that society should help people no matter whether they caused their own disaster or not, they are human beings and this is the best reason to give them a helping hand if they lost the right track. This may be seen as a true milestone of the development in human history. To be part of a “real” community means to help those needy people. What about the idea of humanity and charity, the idea to show compassion with members of ones own community, or with the conception of beneficence? To neglect helpless people seems inappropriate for a community which is devoted to the idea of human flourishing – the basic concept of each sound community.

People who lived a jet-set life should not have a (legal) demand to live such a life again, if they caused a disaster and lost everything and the only way to be better off again would be to let society pay for it. This demand seems unsound but they should live a human being worthy life and society has to pay for it, no matter what the price is. And this account does not contradict with a sophisticated version of a pluralistic egalitarianism. On this point, Anderson cites Arneson who thinks that it might be unfair to make people responsible for their actions in all circumstances since responsible decisions are dependent on necessary capacities – foresight, steadfastness, ability to calculate, strong will, self-confidence – which are partly due to one’s genes or the luck to have good parents. Therefore, those people have a demand on a special paternalistic protection by society with regard to their own bad decisions. Arneson thinks that this could be financed by an obligatory social contribution of the people to a pension scheme. Others, so Anderson, hold the view that a strict compensation of welfare should also be modified by paternalistic intervention. That means only paternalistic reasons could make social contributions obligatory and could justify the distribution of a monthly guaranteed income. Anderson disputes the fact that luck egalitarians show the necessary respect for citizens since they state that people, who had hard luck by virtue of their own fault, ‘earn’ it. She seems to be on the wrong path when she criticises other egalitarians who want to help the badly off people by social insurances on paternalistic reasons. These paternalistic reasons – in order to justify obligatory social insurances – are, in her opinion, a sign of taking citizens to be silly and to be unable to organise their own lives. It is hard to see, so Anderson, how one can expect from citizens not to lose their self-esteem by accepting this kind of justification.

Amy Gutmann criticises Anderson on two points, firstly, she states that even egalitarians should be able to argue that there are special cases – like the guilty car driver case – which are so badly that these people should be helped, even if they got into the miserable situation on their own fault. Secondly, paternalism could be an honourable and compelling principle of legislation. Hence, it must not be humiliating for the state to make laws, for instance, on wearing safety belts, insofar the laws are due to a democratic process. Although Anderson shares the intention of these arguments, she states on the first point that the very idea to guarantee special kind of goods would contradict with the spirit of luck egalitarianism. It might be that this line of argument speaks against luck egalitarianism but not against a sophisticated version of a pluralistic egalitarianism. The safety belt case, so Anderson, is not a good example for restricting the citizen’s liberty with regard to cases in which their liberty is restricted to a great amount, like in cases of coercive partaking of social insurances. The society’s justification should be much stronger than the claim that society knows the citizen’s interests better than they do. There should be no problem for citizens to take part in a social insurance when it is reasonable for them. Under the ‘veil of ignorance,’ to take up Rawl’s famous thought-experiment, everybody would agree on a social insurance if the advantages, for instance not to die in a hospital by virtue of having no insurance at all, rule out the disadvantage of coercive partaking. It seems right that just a few people would like to live in a society where people have to die, because they have not got a social insurance, for whatever reasons. And, if the price for it is to take part in a social insurance, even if it is a liability, one should not hesitate to do so. But, if a person decided not to take part and she is the guilty car driver, she should be helped, no matter what the costs are. This is due to human dignity and there is no sound counterargument why pluralistic egalitarians should not be able to integrate this idea in their conception without losing their track. There is, of course, a practical necessity for every society not to pay for everyone; the social insurances of the state could only finance a limited number of people who do not have – for whatever reasons – a social insurance. Hence, it should be in everybody’s interest, in order to relieve society of high extra costs, to pay for one’s own social insurance. Therefore, it is in society’s interest – and this means in the end in the interest of everybody – to force the people by law to have their own social insurances. In this case, nothing speaks against being forced to one’s own luck.

ii. The Objection of Stigmatizing

The objection of stigmatizing is an objection against the kind of reasons egalitarians have in order to help people who are in terrible situations, which did not arise through their own fault (‘bad brute luck’), for instance, disabled people from birth, or people who became disabled by virtue of an illness or an accident, or people with (very) poor natural talents, and so forth. Anderson thinks, firstly, that there is no care for all badly off people, if one looks at the rules, which lay down who belongs to the ‘bad brute luck’ people, and secondly, the reasons to help the ‘bad brute luck’ people are discriminating for them. The reasons offered to distribute extra resources to handicapped people, so Anderson on the egalitarian view, are wrong because ‘[p]eople lay claim to the resources of egalitarian redistribution in virtue of their inferiority to others, not in virtue of their equality to others’ (Anderson 1999: 306). The principles of distribution are based on pity, which is in her view incompatible with the respect for human dignity. Her main question is, whether a theory of justice, which is based on contemptuous pity for the alleged beneficiaries, could serve egalitarian standards, that equal respect of each human being is the basis of justice. She comes to the conclusion that luck egalitarianism disregards the basic requirements, which every sound egalitarian theory should have.

One might argue that the concern of the ‘equality of fortune’-theorists is based on humanitarian compassion and not on contemptuous pity, but even than, so Anderson, one has to keep the distinctions between the two notions in mind: ‘Compassion is based on an awareness of suffering, an intrinsic condition of a person. Pity, by contrast, is aroused by a comparison of the observer’s condition with the condition of the object of pity’ (Anderson 1999: 306p.). In Anderson’s view, ‘compassion’ says that the person in question is badly off and ‘pity’ says that the person in question is worse off than oneself (‘she is sadly inferior to me’). Both can move one to help others, who are in need, ‘but only pity is condescending.’ But, even for the sake of argument, to take ‘humanitarian compassion’ as a starting point, this would be no sound basis for egalitarian principles of distribution, because compassion aims at relieving suffering and not equalizing it. She states, according to Raz (1986: 242), that once people are relieved of their suffering and neediness, compassion could not generate a further need of an equality of condition. The equality of fortune does not express compassion, it is not about the absolute misery of the person in question, it is about the gap between the best off and the worse off people. The better off people – who are guided by the considerations of luck egalitarianism – have a certain kind of feeling of superiority towards people, who are in need and, vice versa, the badly off people are envious and seek for an equal distribution of resources. Their criterion is an envy-free distribution (Anderson 1999: 306p.).

This may have some plausibility on the first sight, but a second glance shows that she mixed up two aspects, which should be sharply divided, the ‘factum’ of equality and the feeling of inferiority. In detail, her claim that pity is incompatible with human dignity is unsound and the only reason why this claim seems to be justified is that her notion of ‘pity’ is of a certain kind. Anderson’s definition of pity rests on her assumption that ‘pity’ is something that is due to a comparison between the conditions of the people involved and the feeling of those people, who help others who are in need, but, there is no necessity that those, who help others who are in need, have a certain kind of feeling, like, ‘she is really inferior to me’. It might be that some people feel like that, but most people would refuse this kind of talk. They would say that one has to help others who are in need because they are human beings, equal to me, and they did not deserve it to be left alone with their handicap. If one were one of them – one might argue – one would not like to be left alone, either. Anderson’s special definition is incompatible with human dignity, but there are other definitions. But even, so Anderson, if one agrees on humanitarian compassion as starting point for an egalitarian distribution, it would not be enough, since ‘compassion’ aims to ‘relieve suffering’ and not to ‘equalize’ it. According to the compassion view there is no ‘moral judgment on those who suffer’ (Anderson 1999: 307) and there is no further distribution in sight if the suffering of the people has been relieved. This is no objection against the compassion view at all. Firstly, there is no necessity to have a certain kind of feeling, like, ‘she is really inferior to me,’ and secondly, if disabled people are cured, there is no further reason to give them extra resources. They are in a good healthy condition again. Anderson’s main point is that luck egalitarianism claim that disabled people get extra resources by virtue of their inferiority and not by virtue of their equality to other people. One has to differentiate between i.) the improper special feeling of certain kind of people, who help others who are in need (‘she is really inferior to me’) and their motivation to help the needy people, and ii.) the ‘true’ reason why, for instance, disabled people should be treated equally and differently at the same time. Differently, because they get extra resources according to proportional equality, and equally, because they are human beings and should be treated morally equal, according to arithmetical equality. All versions of egalitarianism have one main aspect in common and it may be that Anderson overlooks this important aspect in her talk about what the reasons are to help people who are in need.

iii. The Tutelage Objection

The tutelage objection is against the decision-making of the state – in which category a misery should be placed – and the investigation of the citizens in order to get the relevant information for the state’s decision. This would be, in Anderson’s view, a case of putting the citizens under the tutelage of the state and harming their private sphere (Anderson 1999: 310; also Hayek 1960: 85-102). ‘Equality of fortune,’ so Anderson, says ‘that no one should suffer from undeserved misfortune’ (Anderson 1999: 310). But, in order to determine which people are allowed to get special treatment (res. extra resources) the state must make judgments on the people’s moral responsibility concerning their situation to brute or option luck. In citing Hayek (1960: 95-97) who states that ‘(…) in order to lay a claim to some important benefit, people are forced to obey other people’s judgments of what uses they should have made of their opportunities, rather than following their own judgments’ (Anderson 1999: 310) Anderson concludes that such a system would require the state to make ‘grossly intrusive, moralizing judgments of individual’s choices’ (Anderson 1999: 310). Hence, equality of fortune contradicts with citizen’s privacy and liberty. This is in Korsgaard’s view (1993: 61), on which Anderson is affirmatively referring to, a disrespectful behaviour of the state: ‘But it is disrespectful for the state to pass judgment on how much people are responsible for their expensive tastes or their imprudent choices’ (Anderson 1999: 310).

Her objection against the function of the state to decide which people are morally responsible for their situation according to brute or option luck seems plausible. For the sake of argument, let everybody agree on the point to help people, who suffer from undeserved misfortune. The very question is, then, how the state could organise a system, which treats everyone fairly and with respect. It is a practical necessity that the state decides which people get extra resources financed by the social community. And, it should be no problem to say that, if the state is spending public money, someone has to prove the legitimacy of requests. Therefore, the state needs information and this has nothing to do with harming the people’s liberty or private sphere. It is a hard thing to decide how far this gathering of information by the state should go, of course, no one would like to live in a state where Big Brother is watching you all the time, but one must acknowledge the simple fact that the state has to take precautions not to be deceived by social cheaters. If a person wants public money, she should better have a sound reason, if not, she might be a cheater. It is not about ‘expensive tastes’ or ‘imprudent choices’ (Korsgaard 1993), rather it is about the question if one suffers from undeserved misfortune or not. Anderson is right in stating that there are cases, which could be very complex and, for this reason, might ‘undermine’ the system of distribution. Life is not simple and one has also to cope with those extreme cases. But this special problem always appears according to penumbra cases, the only way out is trying to make well-informed decisions. Not to distribute extra resources to people, who are in need by virtue of undeserved misfortune, might be the wrong decision.

c. The Objection of Complexity

The objection of complexity, which had been brought into the discussion by Lucas (1965, 1977) and Rescher (1966), could also be found in the first chapter of Walzer’s book ‘Spheres of Justice. A Defence of Pluralism and Equality’ (1983: 3-30). His criticism is powerful and illuminating. The main point against egalitarianism is his assumption that the ‘spheres of justice’ are much more complicated than egalitarians believe. Their assumption that equality is the only – or most important – aim (res. principle) of justice is a false monism. There are, according to the prioritarians, other principles of distribution like the principle of merit or desert, the principle of efficiency, or the principle of qualification, and so forth. Nearly every sphere of conduct has special principles of distribution.

Not ‘all’ egalitarians pursue an improper account of egalitarianism. A sophisticated account of pluralistic egalitarianism is much more harder to attack as a simple travesty. Walzer’s ‘relevant reasons approach’ (or theory of ‘complex equality’) is very suitable with regard to different spheres of justice because his account considers special circumstances of the subjects in question. The main difference between his account and luck egalitarianism is, according to the ‘relevant reasons approach,’ that equality is only a by-product of the fulfilment of complex standards of justice and not the aim of justice. There seems to be no strong argument to support the extreme view, that egalitarianism is bound to the assumption that equality is the only aim of justice and not also a by-product; it just had been taken for granted since Feinberg’s famous paper ‘Noncomparative Justice’ (1974, for a critical discussion on Feinberg’s account, see Kane 1996: 380pp.). The objection of complexity tells us that there is no possibility for egalitarians to use different kinds of principles of distribution without losing their egalitarian track (for example, Krebs 2000: 28p.). This assumption seems to be wrong. Firstly, pluralistic egalitarians are not bound to one principle, only; they could also integrate other principles like the principle of autonomy, the principle of liberty and so on without betraying themselves. Secondly, the idea of equality is not restricted to a simple version of result equality (Gosepath 2003: 276), rather to a sophisticated version of proportional equality, which covers different kinds of principles. Hence, there seems to be a close connection to Walzer’s theory of ‘complex equality,’ although one would rather say that his theory is a non-egalitarian account.

4. Two Egalitarian Arguments

One of the main arguments with regard to the egalitarian view is the presumption of equality argument (Berlin 1955/56; Tugendhat 1997; Gosepath 2001) and the argument of pluralistic egalitarianism (Gordon 2006).

a. The Egalitarians’ Assumption of the Presumption of Equality

What about the egalitarians’ assumption of ‘the presumption of equality’? Isaiah Berlin stated in his famous paper ‘Equality as an Ideal’ (1955/56) that equality does not need any justification, but only inequality does. He gives the following example to make his assumption plausible: If someone has a cake and there are 10 people to be taken into account, than, there is no need of justification, automatically, if every person is getting a tenth part. But, if the distributor is not acting according to the principle of equal distribution, he has to give some special reasons for his decision.

Even if common sense justifies Berlin’s ‘argument,’ one has to take into account that the equal distribution – in the example given by Berlin – has no moral advantage with regard to the unequal distribution. Although Frankfurt hold the same view as Berlin does – that the cake should be divided into ten equal parts – he gives a different justification concerning this distribution. The important point is, so Frankfurt, that the distributor in this example has no special reasons to divide the cake in equal parts nor to divide the cake in unequal parts. In one word, he does not know, whether the people should be treated equally concerning a special respect, which could justify an equal distribution, or vice versa. The distributor has no relevant information at all. There are just few philosophers who give reasons why equality needs no justification, others – as Berlin does – take it for granted and/or call for common sense or intuitions. The famous German philosopher Ernst Tugendhat (1997) claims that only inequality needs special reasons. According to Tugendhat, egalitarianism in the strict sense is not about material equal distribution, but about the simple fact that all people have equal moral rights (5), albeit their empirical differences (10). Prioritarians think that there are good reasons to restrict equality (14). Egalitarianism and prioritarianism are not on the same level, since egalitarians – unlike prioritarians – claim for a special proposition. Prioritarians, so Tugendhat, are not bound to a special proposition; their accounts are unlimited concerning the variety of different ‘Konfigurationen,’ (that is the description of duties and rights of a certain moral community, Tugendhat 1997: 5) and hence, prioritarianism claims not for a certain proposition (11). This is the background, according to Tugendhat, for having the justified believe that there is a certain presumption of equality with regard to inequality in the moral realm, albeit this presumption is very ‘thin,’ but it doubtlessly exists (11). In more detail: Regarding an unequal distribution one gives always some reasons why the distribution should not be equal; one is not able to do so concerning an equal distribution (13, 14). If one accepts Tugendhat’s assumption that the primacy of equality is, lastly, due to the structure of moral justification – according to Tugendhat (1997), ‘moral justification’ means that it is an equal justification with respect to all people. The only case of a legitimate justification of inequality is the case, which could be justified with regard to all people (18). Every just distribution has to be equal, unless one is able to justify the reasons concerning the unequal distribution to all people (19) – and not due to a false understanding of an apriori or a dark notion of reason, one might come to the conclusion that his explication is sound. Of course, there are other accounts of philosophers (for example, Kant’s kingdom of ends, Bentham’s all count as one, Gewirth’s principle of generic consistency, or Boylan’s argument for the moral rights of basic goods), but Tugendhat’s account is by virtue of several reasons particularly interesting and illuminating: firstly, he states that egalitarianism is about moral rights in the strict sense of the notion, secondly, he argues that egalitarianism and prioritarianism are not on the same level, and thirdly, he holds the assumption that the primacy of equality is due to the structure of moral justification.

b. Pluralistic Egalitarianism

The extreme ‘egalitarian’ view that equality – in the special sense of comparative equality – is the only aim of justice is wrong, but the other extreme ‘prioritarian’ view that equality has nothing to do with justice is also wrong. The truth is somewhere in-between. There are, at least, four different aspects, which show that justice and equality are (closely) connected with each other: Firstly, according to prioritarians equality is important as a by-product for the fulfilment of absolute standards, for instance, human dignity. Secondly, relational (res. comparative) equality is one aspect of justice among others; one need relational equality in order to yield, for example, legal equality, equality of chances, or antidiscrimination laws. Thirdly, equality is indispensable in being a joint starting point with regard to political autonomy, social membership, or liberty of exchange because absolute standards presuppose that people’s life prospects are more or less the same. Fourthly, equality is (also) a result of political autonomy insofar as there seem to exist special cases according to which an equal distribution is rightly demanded (for example, the Norwegian public oil reserves).

It seems that the opposition between philosophers who are egalitarians and philosophers who are prioritarians according to Miller (1990) is a false one, and better be ‘understood as a debate about whether one particular kind of equality – economic equality, say – should be pursued or not’ (Miller 1997: 222). He may be right in stating that ‘there are two different kinds of valuable equality, one connected with justice, and the other standing independently’ (Miller 1997: 224). He suggests a so-called third way: ‘Equality of the first kind is distributive in nature. It specifies that benefits of a certain kind – rights, for instance – should be distributed equally, because justice requires this. The second kind of equality is not in this sense distributive. It does not specify directly any distribution of rights or resources. Instead it identifies a social ideal, the ideal of a society in which people regard and treat one another as equals, in other words a society that is not marked by status divisions such that one can place different people in hierarchically ranked categories, in different classes for instance. We can call this second kind of equality equality of status, or simply social equality.’ (Miller 1997: 224). Miller seems right in saying that the two different notions of equality are not closely enough separated in the debate. According to Nagel (1979: chapter 3-6) everybody think that moral equality – or mutatis mutandis ‘social equality’ in Miller’s words – is something all people acknowledge, but the crux is that the interpretations diverge, for instance, with regard to utilitarians (chapter 4), the position of individual rights (chapter 5), and egalitarians (chapter 6). A plausible social ethics, so Nagel, would be influenced by all three accounts (chapter 7). Miller’s assumption that social equality is something that is not part of justice seems premature. Tugendhat seems right in stating that egalitarianism in the strict sense is about moral rights, hence, social equality as such is one part of justice. If one restricts a person’s moral rights, one better give sound reasons why one does not treat her equally according to others, if one is not able to give a plain justification, one treats her unjustly. This has nothing to do with any kind of distributions, although Miller seems to hold the claim that moral rights could also be distributed. Some egalitarians cite Aristotle’s famous propositions that, firstly, it is just that equal people get equal shares and unequal people get unequal shares, and secondly, it is unjust that equal people get unequal shares and unequal people get equal shares (EN V, 6) to back up their main hypothesis that the presumption of equality follows directly from Aristotle’s account of formal equality. It is apparent that they did not analyse the whole context of these propositions. The argument of ‘the presumption of equality’ should not be based on this passage. Instead, the passage could be turned against the prioritarian view that egalitarians are bound to a form of result equality.

‘And the same equality will exist between the persons and between the things concerned; for as the latter – the things concerned – are related, so are the former; if they are not equal, they will not have what is equal, but this is the origin of quarrels and complaints – when either equals have and are awarded unequal shares, or unequals equal shares. Further, this is plain from the fact that awards should be according to merit; for all men agree that what is just in distribution must be according to merit in some sense, though they do not all specify the same sort of merit, but democrats identify it with the status of freeman, supporters of oligarchy with wealth (or with noble birth), and supporters of aristocracy with excellence.’ (Aristotle EN V, 6 1131a20-1131a29)

Aristotle states that there is always trouble if unequals get equal shares, that means, if equals get unequal shares or unequals get equal shares. But, there is no claim in the cited passage, which says that all people should be treated equally (presumption of equality), rather all people should be treated equally according to a special axia, namely the political virtue. According to Aristotle’s account of justice in Book V of the Nicomachean Ethics one has to acknowledge the fact that the proposition ‘equals should get equal shares’ is due to the principle of proportional equality (distributional justice), and should not be seen under the heading of ‘justice in exchanges’ (Aristotle EN V, 5 1131a) – where the principle of arithmetical equality exists – which is about justice concerned with exchanges according to reciprocity (EN V, 8) and retributive justice (EN V, 7). To put it in a nutshell, the formal principle of equality – equals should get equal shares or in a different formula equal cases should be treated equally – is empty, and the prioritarians, on the one hand, are right in saying that egalitarians are wrong in their assumption that the presumption of equality is due to this formal principle. Aristotle’s approach to fill it is his account of proportional equality. On the other hand, there is hardly any sound argument – with respect to the debate between egalitarians and prioritarians – that would claim for the special proposition that egalitarians are restricted to ‘result equality,’ and not also to ‘proportional equality’ within a sophisticated version of pluralistic egalitarianism (for example, Gosepath 2004). Some prioritarians forget the simple point that there are two ways of taking other people’s condition into account, firstly, by proportional equality, and secondly, by stipulating absolute standards of justice.

Equality as the only aim of justice or as a mere by-product of justice is an unhappy distinction to follow. Justice cannot be reduced to equality alone and the importance of equality is too great to be a mere appendage. The prioritarians are right in their criticism that it would be absurd to strive for equality for its own sake; but they forgot that hardly any sophisticated version of egalitarianism is doing so (or would do so). It seems unsound, when people hold the view that all human beings should be treated equally by virtue of the simple fact that the ideal of equality should be fulfilled for its own sake. Instead, the demand of treating people morally equal may give some hints for equal distributions in other spheres (see also Gosepath 2001). But, as Walzer nicely puts it, nearly each sphere needs its own standard, and therefore, it might be right not to choose between the egalitarian or prioritarian view but to combine both accounts. According to this, Gosepath (2001) suggests that proportional equality could be a good basis for a sound discussion between egalitarian and prioritarian theories of justice.

There is a close connection between justice and equality, firstly, a conceptual connection, and secondly, a normative connection. First, equality is a necessary condition for justice, since one is not able to give a full explication on the notion of justice without taking formal and proportional equality into account (see Aristotle EN V). The stipulation of absolute standards of justice, for instance human dignity, is something, which should be incorporated. But it should be clear that the stipulation of absolute standards is not enough, one should also take the egalitarian model into account. Second, in his famous example of a ruler who fries his subjects in oil and, afterwards, also fries himself Frankena (1962: 1 and 17) is stating that the ruler acts immorally but not against the ideal of equality. This is the reason why formal and proportional justices form a necessary but not a sufficient condition. The normative connection between justice and equality tries to solve this problem and acts as a shield against such and alike cases by providing a standard of normative constraints (for example, human rights).

5. Reference and Further Reading

  • Anderson, E. (1999): “What is the Point of Equality?,” in: Ethics, Vol. 109, 287-337.
  • Aristoteles (1990): Ethica Nicomachea, Bywater, I. (Ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Aristotle (1995): Nicomachean Ethics, Ross, W. D./ Urmson, J. O. (trans.), in: Barnes, J. (Ed.): The Complete Works of Aristotle, Vol. II., Princeton: University Press.
  • Arneson, R. (1989): “Equality and Equal Opportunity for Welfare,” in: Philosophical Studies, Vol. 56, 77-93.
  • Arneson, R. (2000): “Luck Egalitarianism and Prioritarianism,” in: Ethics, Vol. 110, 339-349.
  • Barry, B. (1991): Liberty and Justice, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Bentham, J. (1996): “An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation,” in: Burns, J.H., Hart, H.L.A. (Ed.): The Collected Works of Jeremy Bentham, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Berlin, I. (1955/56): “Equality as an Ideal,” in: Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Vol. 61, 301-326.
  • Boylan, M. (2004): A Just Society, Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • Cohen, G. (1989): “On the Currency of Egalitarian Justice,” in: Ethics, Vol. 99, 906-944.
  • Cupit, G. (2000): “The Basis of Equality,” in: The Journal of the Royal Institute of Philosophy, Vol. 75, 291, 105-125.
  • Dworkin, R. (1981): “What is Equality? Part 1: Equality of Welfare,” in: Philosophy and Public Affairs, Vol. 10, No. 3, 185-246.
  • Dworkin, R. (1981): “What is Equality? Part 2: Equality of Resources,” in: Philosophy and Public Affairs, Vol. 10, No. 4, 283-345.
  • Feinberg, J. (1963): “Justice and Personal Desert,” in: Friedrich, v./ Chapman, J. (Eds.): Justice, New York: Atherton, 69-97.
  • Feinberg, J. (1974): “Noncomparative Justice,” in: Philosophical Review, Vol. 83, No. 3, 297-338.
  • Frankena, W. (1962): “The Concept of Social Justice,” in: Brandt, R. (Ed.): Social Justice, Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall, 1-29.
  • Frankfurt, H. (1987): “Equality as a Moral Ideal,” in: Ethics, Vol. 98, 21-42.
  • Frankfurt, H. (1997): “Equality and Respect,” in: Social Research, Vol. 64, No. 1, 3-15.
  • Gewirth, A. (1981): Reason and Morality, Chicago: The University of Chicago Press.
  • Gordon, J.-S. (2006): “Justice or Equality?,” in: Journal for Business, Economics & Ethics, Vol. 7 (2), 183-201
  • Gosepath, S. (2001): “Über den Zusammenhang von Gerechtigkeit und Gleichheit,” in: Wingert, L./ Günther, G. (Eds.): Die Öffentlichkeit der Vernunft und die Vernunft der Öffentlichkeit. Festschrift für Jürgen Habermas, Frankfurt a. M.: Suhrkamp, 403-433.
  • Gosepath, S. (2003): “Verteidigung egalitärer Gerechtigkeit,” in: Deutsche Zeitschrift für Philosophie, Vol. 51, 275-297.
  • Gosepath, S. (2004): Gleiche Gerechtigkeit. Grundlagen eines liberalen Egalitarismus, Frankfurt a. M.: Suhrkamp.
  • Hayek, F. A. von (1960): The Constitution of Liberty, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • Kane, J. (1996): “Justice, Impartiality, and Equality. Why the Concept of Justice does not Presume Equality,” in: Political Theory, Vol. 24, No. 3, 375-393.
  • Kant, I. (1999): Grundlegung zur Metaphysik der Sitten, Hamburg: Meiner.
  • Korsgaard, C. (1993): “Commentary on G. A. Cohen and Amartya Sen,” in: Nussbaum, M./ Sen, A. (Eds.): The Quality of Life, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 54-61.
  • Krebs, A. (2000): “Einleitung,” in: Krebs, A. (Ed.): Gerechtigkeit oder Gleichheit. Texte der neuen Egalitariamuskritik, Frankfurt a. M.: Suhrkamp, 7-37.
  • Krebs, A. (2003): “Warum Gerechtigkeit nicht als Gleichheit zu begreifen ist,” in: Deutsche Zeitschrift für Philosophie, Vol. 51, 235-253.
  • Lucas, J. (1965): “Against Equality,” in: Philosophy, Vol. 40, 296-307.
  • Lucas, J. (1977): “Against Equality Again,” in: Philosophy, Vol. 52, 255-280.
  • MacLeod, C. (1998): Liberalism, Justice, and Markets, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Mill, J. S. (1972): Utilitarianism, Acton, H. B. (Ed.), London: Dent.
  • Miller, D. (1990): “Equality,” in: Hunt, G. (Ed.): Philosophy and Politics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 77-98.
  • Miller, D. (1997): “Equality and Justice,” in: Ratio: An International Journal of Analytic Philosophy, Vol. 10, No. 3, 222-237.
  • Nagel, T. (1979): “Equality,” in: Nagel, T. (Ed.): Mortal Questions, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 106-127.
  • Parijs, P. van (1991): “Why Surfers Should Be Fed: The Liberal Case for an Unconditional Basic Income,” in: Philosophy and Public Affairs, Vol. 20, 101-131.
  • Parijs, P. van (1995): Real Freedom for All. What (if Anything) Can Justify Capitalism?, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Parfit, D. (1998): “Equality and Priority,” in: Mason, A. (Ed.): Ideals of Equality, Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1-20.
  • Pufendorf, S. (1672/1934): De iure naturae et gentium libri octo, Oldfather, C H./ W. A. (transl.): The Law of Nature and Nations Eight Books, Vol. II., Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Rakowski, E. (1991): Equal Justice, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Rawls, J. (1971): A Theory of Justice, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
  • Rawls, J. (1993): Political Liberalism, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Raz, J. (1986): The Morality of Freedom, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Rescher, N. (1966): Distributive Justice. A Constructive Critique of the Utilitarian Theory of Distribution, Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company.
  • Roemer, J. (1992): “The Morality and Efficiency of Market Socialism,” in: Ethics, Vol. 102, 448- 464.
  • Roemer, J. (1996): Theories of Distributive Justice, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
  • Roemer, J. (1998): Equality of Opportunity, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Sen, A. (1992): Inequality Reexamined, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Tugendhat, E. (1997): “Gleichheit und Universalität in der Moral,” in: Tugendhat, E. (Ed.): Moralbegründung und Gerechtigkeit, Münster: Lit, 3-28.
  • Walzer, M. (1983): Spheres of Justice. A Defence of Pluralism and Equality, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.

Author Information

John-Stewart Gordon
Email: john-stewart.gordon@rub.de
Ruhr-University Bochum
Germany

The Einstein-Podolsky-Rosen Argument and the Bell Inequalities

See the PDF Version.

Author Information

László E. Szabó
Email: leszabo@phil.elte.hu
Eötvös University
Hungary

Evidence

The concept of evidence is crucial to epistemology and the philosophy of science. In epistemology, evidence is often taken to be relevant to justified belief, where the latter, in turn, is typically thought to be necessary for knowledge. Arguably, then, an understanding of evidence is vital for appreciating the two dominant objects of epistemological concern, namely, knowledge and justified belief. In the philosophy of science, evidence is taken to be what confirms or refutes scientific theories, and thereby constitutes our grounds for rationally deciding between competing pictures of the world. In view of this, an understanding of evidence would be indispensable for comprehending the proper functioning of the scientific enterprise.

For these reasons and others, a philosophical appreciation of evidence becomes pressing. Section 1 examines what might be called the nature of evidence. It considers the theoretical roles that evidence plays, with a view towards determining what sort of entity evidence can be—an experience, a proposition, an object, and so on. In doing so, it also considers the extent to which evidence is implicated in justified belief (and by extension, knowledge, if knowledge requires justified belief). Then, section 2 considers the evidential relationship, or the relation between two things by virtue of which one counts as evidence for the other; and it explores the nature of their relationship, that is, whether the relationship is deductive, explanatory, or probabilistic. Finally, equipped with this theoretical background, section 3 looks at some of the important problems and paradoxes that have occupied those working in the theory of evidence.

Table of Contents

  1. The Nature of Evidence: What Is It and What Does It Do?
    1. Propositional Evidence in Explanatory, Probabilistic and Deductive Reasoning
    2. Can Experiences Be Evidence? The Regress Argument
    3. Evidence and Justified Belief: A Closer Look
  2. Theories of the Evidential Relation
    1. Probabilistic Theories
    2. Semi-Probabilistic Theories
    3. Qualitative Theories
      1. Hypothetico-Deductivism
      2. Evidence as a Positive Instance
      3. Bootstrapping
  3. Some Problems of Evidence
    1. The Ravens Paradox
      1. Hempel’s “Solution”
      2. A Bayesian Solution
      3. An Error-Statistical Solution
    2. The Grue Paradox
      1. Goodman’s Solution
      2. Achinstein’s Solution
    3. Underdetermination of Theory by Evidence
      1. Underdetermination and Holism: the Duhem-Quine Problem
      2. A Bootstrapping Solution
      3. A Bayesian Solution
  4. References and Further Reading

1. The Nature of Evidence: What Is It and What Does It Do?

When we think about examples of evidence from everyday life, we tend to think of evidence, in the first place, as consisting of an object or set of objects. Consider evidence that might be found at a crime scene: a gun, a bloody knife, a set of fingerprints, or hair, fiber or DNA samples. The same might be said of fossil evidence, or evidence in medicine, such as when an X-ray is evidence that a patient has a tumor, or koplic spots as evidence that a patient has measles. Yet we also consider such things as testimony and scientific studies to be evidence, examples difficult to classify as “objects” since they apparently involve linguistic entities. Possibilities proliferate when we turn to philosophical accounts of evidence, where we find more exotic views on what sort of thing evidence can be. In philosophy, evidence has been taken to consist of such things as experiences, propositions, observation-reports, mental states, states of affairs, and even physiological events, such as the stimulation of one’s sensory surfaces.

Can all of these count as evidence? Few would think so, and basic principles of parsimony seem to militate against it. But given all of the possibilities with which philosophy and everyday life present us, how would we go about making a decision? What kind of consideration could determine the sorts of entities that can count as evidence? A natural strategy to pursue would be to consider the role or function evidence plays in both philosophy and everyday life. That is, perhaps considering what evidence does affords the best clue to what evidence is.

a. Propositional Evidence in Explanatory, Probabilistic and Deductive Reasoning

One way to approach the matter is to consider the role of evidence in certain kinds of reasoning in which we engage. Recently, such a strategy has led Timothy Williamson to the conclusion that evidence must be propositional—that is, that it must consist in a proposition or set of propositions (Williamson 2000, pp. 194-200). Although Williamson declines to give any theoretical account of propositions, minimally we may take propositions to be the bearers of truth and falsity (what is true or false), the contents of assertions (what is said or asserted) and the objects of propositional attitudes (e.g. what is believed or known). More generally, propositions may be taken to be the referents of that-clauses: for instance, I believe or know that the house is on fire; it is true or false that the Orioles won last night; I said or asserted that Jones is a thief; and so on.

To begin with, Williamson points out that evidence is often featured in explanatory reasoning, in the sense that we tend to infer to the hypothesis that provides the best explanation of the evidence. Whatever else evidence may be, then, at the very least it is the kind of thing that hypotheses explain. But what hypotheses explain, Williamson contends, are propositions; we use hypotheses to explain why such-and-such is the case, and so what is explained—the evidence—is that such-and-such is the case. By contrast, it makes no sense whatsoever to explain an object; we cannot explain this knife, for example. What we might explain, however, is something true about this knife, such as that it is bloody. Here, the evidence would be that the knife is bloody—again, a proposition, not an object. Nor, on Williamson’s view, would it make sense to explain a sensory experience. The hypothesis that I have a cold does not explain the tickle in my throat, but would explain why I have a tickle in my throat. Again, what is explained—the evidence—is that I have a tickle in my throat, not the experience itself. Accordingly, if we consider the role of evidence in explanatory reasoning, it seems that evidence is propositional.

Additionally, Williamson claims that we use evidence to engage in explicitly probabilistic reasoning, where such reasoning may or may not be explanatory. For instance, we often compare the probabilities of competing hypotheses H and H’ on a common body of evidence, E. One way to do so would be to consider the ratio:

P(H)P(E/H)
P(H´)P(E/H´)

(In general, the symbols P(X/Y) mean the probability of X given Y). Here, we would compare the probability of the hypotheses, given the evidence, only by considering the probability of the evidence, given the hypotheses. It follows that evidence must be the sort of thing that can have a probability. But again, Williamson claims that what has a probability is a proposition; for example, it can only be probable or improbable that such-and-such is the case. Even when we speak loosely of the probability of an event, what we mean, says Williamson, is the probability that the event will occur. And surely, such things as objects or experiences cannot be probable or improbable, although it could be probable or improbable that I have an experience under certain conditions, or that an object has a certain property. So again, granted that we engage in probabilistic reasoning with evidence, the conclusion seems to be that evidence must be propositional.

Finally, Williamson points out that we often think of evidence as ruling out certain hypotheses. For instance, that I was in Cleveland at the time of the murder rules out the hypothesis that I was the murderer in Columbus. But evidence E rules out an hypothesis H only when the two are logically inconsistent; in particular, one must be able to deduce ~H from E. And, of course, the premises in a logical deduction consist of propositions—the sort of thing that can be true or false. Indeed, a valid deduction is one such that, if the premises are true, the conclusion must also be true.

Yet, one may well remain unconvinced by these arguments. For example, must the object of an explanation be a proposition, rather than, say, an event? When Newton offered an explanation for the action of the tides, one’s first thought is that he was out to explain a physical occurrence taking place on the surface of the earth, and not anything like the content of an assertion or the referent of a that-clause. Indeed, we might raise the same issue with Williamson’s claim about probabilities. There are well-known interpretations of probability according to which events and event-types have probabilities, and not propositions. For instance, on the standard frequency interpretation, a probability is the limit to the relative frequency of an event-type in a reference class; and on the propensity interpretation, a probability is the disposition of a system—such as an experimental arrangement— to yield a particular outcome, which is manifestly not a proposition. In defense of Williamson, however, his strategy is to consider the function of evidence in particular types of reasoning. And as he frequently points out, if one is to reason with one’s evidence, either probabilistically, deductively, or explanatorily, the evidence must be the sort of thing that one can grasp or understand, namely, a proposition. (It makes little sense to grasp an event, although we can grasp that an event took place). So, while there may be theories of probability or explanation whereby events are implicated, when we turn to explanatory, probabilistic or deductive reasoning with the evidence, we are arguably dealing only with what is propositional.

Whether or not we agree with Williamson, we shall see in the next section, where we consider the important role evidence plays—namely, as something that justifies belief—that we may have strong theoretical ground for accepting, contrary to Williamson, that experiences can also count as evidence.

b. Can Experiences Be Evidence? The Regress Argument

It seems almost a truism that whether a person’s belief is reasonable or unreasonable—justified or not—depends upon the evidence he possesses. For instance, if I believe that my wife is having an affair, but I have no evidence at all to think so, then such a belief seems patently unreasonable. Given my lack of evidence, I am not justified in holding the belief, and rationality would demand that I relinquish it. If, on the contrary, I have overwhelming evidence in support of my wife’s infidelity, but persist in believing that she is being faithful, then such a belief would be equally unreasonable. In this situation, the only belief I would be justified in having, in the light of my evidence, is that my wife is indeed having an affair. Arguably, then, there is another important role that evidence plays: evidence is that which justifies a person’s belief. We shall examine the matter in more detail below (§1c).

This being granted, suppose we were to accept, in addition, that evidence consists only in propositions, as was urged in §1a. If so, the natural conclusion would be that what justifies a subject’s belief are other propositions he believes (his evidence). More formally, we would say that, for any proposition p that a subject S believes at a time t, if S is justified in believing p at t, there must be at least one other proposition q that S believes at t, which counts as S’s evidence for p. But if this is so, it seems we should also require that S’s belief in q itself be justified; for if S is groundlessly assuming q, how could it justify his belief in p? Yet if S’s belief that q must be justified, then by the same reasoning S must possess evidence for q, consisting in yet another proposition r that S is justified in believing. And, of course, there shall have to be another proposition serving as S’s evidence for r. The question is: where, if at all, does this chain of justifications terminate? We refer to this as the epistemic regress problem. As we shall soon see, the regress problem may support the conclusion that experiences can count as evidence as well (see especially Audi 2003).

Now, granted that we cannot possibly entertain an infinite number of justifying propositions, one possible way out of the regress would be simply to reject an assumption used to generate it, namely, that only propositions a person believes can count as his evidence. If we reject this assumption, perhaps we can hold, on the one hand, that the regress does terminate in what S is justified in believing, but on the other, the evidence for these beliefs does not consist in other propositions he believes. And aren’t we perfectly familiar with such cases? Consider beliefs we have about our own perceptual experiences. I believe that I have a pain in my lower back. What justifies this belief is surely not some other belief I have, but simply my experience of pain in my lower back. Here, the belief is grounded directly in the perceptual experience itself, and not in any other proposition I believe. Or consider my belief that there is something yellow in my visual field. Again, what justifies this belief is not any other proposition I believe, but simply my experience of something yellow in my visual field. Moreover, the point arguably need not be limited to beliefs about our perceptual experiences (Audi, 2003; see also Pryor 2000). For example, suppose I hear thunder and a patter at my window, and come to believe that it is raining outside. That it is raining outside is not a belief about my perceptual experiences, yet seems to be grounded in them.

The idea, then, would be that the regress of justifications terminates in a body of beliefs grounded directly in the evidence of the senses, and not by any other beliefs that would themselves need to be justified. This maneuver would terminate the regress, precisely because—unlike a belief—it makes no sense to demand evidence for an experience. Indeed, how can I give evidence for a pain in my lower back? At the same time, experiences do seem to justify certain beliefs, ostensibly making this an ideal solution to the regress problem. It is worth noting that, since this view postulates a body of beliefs that ultimately support all other beliefs without resting on any beliefs themselves, it is an instance of a more general position on the structure of justification known as foundationalism.

While this line of thought may give some reason for accepting that experiences count as evidence, it still does not tell us anything about the particular relationship between experience and belief by virtue of which the former can constitute evidence for the latter. Indeed, if Williamson’s arguments from §1a are correct, we know that experience can neither stand in an explanatory, nor probabilistic or deductive relationship with a proposition believed. By virtue of what sort of relationship, then, can a subject’s experience count as evidence for what he believes? Donald Davidson (1990) has argued that experience can only stand in a causal relationship to belief. For example, my hearing thunder and a patter at the window merely causes me to believe that it is raining outside. For Davidson and others, this is the wrong sort of relationship to account for justification; what we need for the latter is not the sort of relationship in which billiard balls can stand, but the sort of relationship that propositions can stand—again, like an explanatory, probabilistic or deductive relationship. Accordingly, like Williamson, Davidson claims that only propositions a person believes can count as evidence for his other beliefs, and opts for a coherence theory of the structure of justification (and knowledge), rather than a foundationist theory.

Engaging further with Davidson’s claim would take us too far afield. For our purposes, it suffices to say that many philosophers still do think that experience can count as evidence. Indeed, some, such as John McDowell (1996), think that experiences have conceptual and even propositional content—we can see, hear, feel that such-and-such is the case—and thus that experiences can stand in rational relationships to beliefs, and not just causal ones. Part of the urgency for McDowell is that, in his view, the very survival of empiricism demands that experiences count as evidence; indeed, Davidson, who denies this, is perfectly happy to retire empiricism.

However, even those who deny that experiences count as evidence need not think that a person’s experiences are irrelevant to the evidence he possesses. For instance, Williamson entertains the possibility that there are some propositions that would not count as a person’s evidence unless he was undergoing some kind of experience. According to Williamson, in such a case, experience may be said to provide evidence, without constituting it. Whether this will be seen as sufficient to save empiricism depends, of course, on how one understands that doctrine.

c. Evidence And Justified Belief: A Closer Look

Recall that in order to start the regress in §1b, we assumed that evidence is that which justifies a person’s belief. This view can be generalized to cover all so-called doxastic or belief-involving attitudes—belief, disbelief, suspension of belief, and even partial belief. The idea would simply be that S’s doxastic attitude D toward a proposition p at a time t is epistemically justified at t, if and only if having D toward p fits the evidence S has at t. This view, known as evidentialism, makes justification turn entirely on the evidence a person possesses (Conee and Feldman, 2004). But is evidentialism inevitable? Is having evidence sufficient for justified belief? Is it even necessary?

Consider, first, whether possessing evidence is sufficient for justified belief. Some think that justified belief is essentially a deontological notion, involving the fulfillment of one’s duties or responsibilities as a believer. Hence, while having a belief that fits one’s evidence might be implicated in responsible belief, it seems that responsibility also requires making proper use of one’s evidence. For example, suppose I am justified in believing p, and that I am justified in believing that if p then q. Yet, I do not believe q on the basis of this evidence, but believe it simply because I like the way it sounds (Korblith, 1980). If I believe q on these grounds, I am arguably not justified in my belief, even though it “fits” my other beliefs; believing a proposition because of the way it sounds seems like a patently irresponsible and therefore unjustified belief, no matter what unused evidence for it I may possess. In defense of evidentialism here, Conee and Feldman appeal to the auxiliary notion of a well-founded belief: a belief that not only fits the evidence a person possesses, but is properly based upon it. Thus, in the above example, my belief in q is not well-founded, since I do not properly use my evidence, even though the belief is justified by the evidence I possess. This maneuver may do little, however, to placate those who take justified belief to be inextricably related to responsibility.

Perhaps a more pressing challenge to the evidentialist is whether evidence is even necessary for justified belief. Consider again believing a proposition because of the way it sounds. Intuitively, such a process or method of adopting beliefs is horribly unreliable; that is, one is not at all likely to arrive at true beliefs in this way. By contrast, consider the inference from “p” and “if p then q” to the conclusion “q. If the former two are true, then believing q on their bases is guaranteed to result in a true belief; indeed, sound deductive reasoning is the very paradigm of a reliable or truth-conducive process of inference. Accordingly, perhaps the central notion involved in justified belief is not the responsibility or possession of evidence per se, but how truth-conducive or reliable one’s belief-forming process or method is. If so, this opens up the possibility that there are instances of justified belief in which evidence is not implicated at all; for, while making proper use of one’s evidence is surely one way to form beliefs reliably, there is no reason to suspect that it is the only way to do so. Indeed, consider again beliefs formed on the basis of perceptual experience. Perhaps the reason why such beliefs are justified is not because experience is somehow evidence for such a belief; nor even because experience provides evidence for other propositions, as in Williamson’s view; but simply because forming beliefs via experience is generally a reliable or truth-conducive process of belief-formation. This view, which relates justified belief to the reliability of the process by which it is formed, is known as reliabilism (see especially Goldman, 1976, 1986).

It is far from clear, though, how far reliabilism can decouple justified belief from evidence (see Bonjour 1980, but also Brandom 2000). As the view has thus far been described, a belief can be justified even if one has no evidence whatsoever for believing that the process by which the belief is formed is reliable; all that matters is that the belief-forming process be reliable, not that the subject has any reason to think that it is. Indeed, reliabilism is typically thought to involve the thesis of epistemic externalism, or the thesis that one need have no access to or awareness of what makes one’s beliefs justified. With this in mind, consider the well-known case of the industrial chicken-sexer, who can reliably discriminate between male and female chickens without having any idea of how he does so. Suppose we take someone with that ability, but withhold from him whether he is successfully discriminating chickens by sex; that is, he not only has no idea how he reliably discriminates between chickens, but does not even know whether he does so. Would such a person really be justified in believing that a particular chicken is female, even though he hasn’t the slightest clue that he possesses the ability of the chicken sexer? What if we told him that he gets it wrong the majority of the time? Here, he would have evidence against his own reliability. Would he be justified then? Even reliabilists such as Alvin Goldman (1986) take heed here, requiring among other things that a believer must not possess evidence against the reliability of the belief-forming process. This, together with the notion that proper use of one’s evidence counts as a reliable process, ensures that the concept of evidence will not be utterly irrelevant to justified belief, even if we were to reject the strong thesis of evidentialism in favor of something like reliabilism.

Up to this point, we have merely been considering what might be called the nature of evidence: what it is and what it does. And although it has been suggested that evidence can stand in an explanatory, probabilistic, or deductive relationship with a proposition it supports, very little has been said about these relationships. That is, we have yet to consider any theories on the evidential relation, or the relation between two things by virtue of which one counts as evidence for or against the other. It is to this topic that we now turn.

In order to avoid biasing the question of what sort of entity evidence can be, where possible, I will simply refer to the evidence as “E” (although, if Williamson is correct, E will have to be a proposition in each of the theories we shall consider).

2. Theories of the Evidential Relation

A theory of the evidential-relation provides conditions necessary and sufficient for the truth of claims of the form

E is evidence for H.

Such a theory tells us, in philosophically enriched terms, what it is for something, E, to constitute evidence for a proposition or hypothesis, H. There are surely many ways to classify such theories, but one intuitive way to do so would be to divide them into probabilistic, semi-probabilistic, and non-probabilistic or qualitative theories; the first two types of theory feature probabilities at least somewhere in their accounts of evidence, while the latter type avoids reference to probabilities altogether. We will look at probabilistic and semi-probabilistic accounts first.

a. Probabilistic Theories of the Evidential Relation

The most widely accepted probabilistic account of evidence is the so-called increase-in-probability or positive- relevance account. The idea is simply that E is evidence for H if and only if E makes H more probable. In symbols, E is evidence for H if and only if

P(H/E) > P(H)

where this is to be interpreted as saying that the probability of H given E is greater than the probability of H alone. Along similar lines, we can say that E is evidence against H if and only if

P(H/E) < P(H).

Finally, we may say that E is neither evidence for, nor against, H iff

P(H/E) = P(H).

Of course, these definitions are purely formal, and will take on deeper philosophical significance if we interpret the concept of probability employed. Most prominently, subjective Bayesians interpret a probability as a rational subject’s degree of belief in a proposition at a given time t, where the only condition necessary for a subject to count as rational is that his degrees of belief conform to the axioms of the probability calculus. So, for example, where H and H´ are logically incompatible hypotheses, the degree to which a rational subject believes [H or H´] ought to be equal to the degree to which he believes H plus the degree to which he believes H´, since [P(H v H´) = P(H) + P(H´)] is an axiom of the probability calculus. With this interpretation of probability in mind, the positive-relevance definition of evidence says that E is evidence for H, for a rational subject S at a time t, if and only if E would make S believe H more, were he to learn that E is the case. Naturally, then, evidence against H would make a rational subject believe H less, and evidence that is neutral towards H would leave a rational subject’s degree of belief in H unchanged.

As intuitive as these definitions may seem, some think that these simple probabilistic definitions are subject to serious counterexamples, and either try to supplement the probabilistic definition with other concepts, such as explanation, or reject the quantitative approach altogether. Consider a simple counterexample to positive-relevance offered by Achinstein (1983, 2001), devised to show that a mere increase in probability is not sufficient for something to count as evidence. Let E = On Wednesday, Steve was doing training laps in the water; let H = On Wednesday, Steve drowned; and let our background information include that Steve is a member of the Olympic swimming team who was in fine shape Wednesday morning. Achinstein claims that E increases the probability of H over the probability of H alone; that is, swimming makes drowning more probable than when one is not swimming at all. According to the positive relevance definition, then, E ought to be evidence that H. But this is bizarre, for the mere fact that Steve—an Olympian—is doing training laps on Wednesday seems to provide no reason at all to believe that he drowned. Intuitively, the idea behind the counterexample is that positive-relevance is too weak to capture a notion of evidence; E can increase the probability of H without being evidence for it at all. (For responses to this and other counterexamples of Achinstein’s, see Kronz (1992), Maher (1996) and Roush (2005)).

Clark Glymour (1980) has offered a very widely discussed objection to positive-relevance, specifically under its subjective Bayesian interpretation, now known as the “problem of old evidence.” According to Bayesians, the first term in the positive-relevance definition, P(H/E), is to be determined by way of a theorem of the probability calculus known as Bayes’ theorem, which in its simplest formulation is:

P(H/E) = P(H) x P(E/H) / P(E)

With this in mind, Glymour points out that quite often scientists advance an hypothesis to explain “old evidence,” or some phenomenon that is already known to obtain. For example, one known phenomenon that Einstein’s general theory of relativity was advanced to explain was an anomaly in Mercury’s orbit, known as the anomalous advance of the perihelion of Mercury. In these cases, P(E) in the above theorem would equal 1; that is, since the phenomenon is already known to obtain, a rational subject would believe that E obtains with certainty. Assuming now that the theory (being an adequate explanation) entails the phenomenon, then P(E/H) above would be 1 as well. But note that if we plug these figures into the theorem above, the theorem simply reduces to: P(H/E) = P(H). According to our relevance definitions, then, old evidence could neither be evidence for, nor against, an hypothesis. But clearly old evidence can be evidence for, or against, an hypothesis, as was certainly the case with the anomaly in Mercury’s orbit: it was evidence for Einstein’s theory and evidence against Newton’s. Considerations such as these lead Glymour to eschew probabilities altogether in his own influential theory of evidence (see §2c below). (For a subjective Bayesian response to the problem of old evidence, see especially Howson and Urbach (1996)).

One might think that we can easily devise a probabilistic definition of evidence in order to circumvent these problems. Suppose, for example, we say that E is evidence for H, if and only if the probability of H given E is high (Carnap, 1950). Call this the high-probability definition of evidence. In symbols, E is evidence for H if and only if

P(H/E) > k

where k is some threshold of high probability. This would avoid Achinstein’s swimming counterexample, for while swimming does increase the probability of drowning, it does not render it high. Moreover, since it avoids making increase-and-decrease-in-probability a criterion of evidence, it would not face Glymour’s problem of old evidence. But suppose E = Jones has regularly taken his wife’s birth-control pills over the last year, and H = Jones has not become pregnant. Clearly, P(H/E) is as high as can be, but the fact that Jones has taken his wife’s birth-control pills is surely not evidence that he has not become pregnant. The problem, of course, is one of the evidence being relevant to the hypothesis, a problem that will surface again with other accounts of evidence, as we shall see below (§§2ci, 3c).

b. Semi-Probabilistic Theories of Evidence

While an elegant probabilistic definition of evidence may be desirable, these objections and others have suggested to some that such an account might be unattainable. However, not all philosophers who have been skeptical of a purely probabilistic approach have abandoned probabilities altogether.

Achinstein (1983, 2001), for example, accepts the high probability definition as a necessary but not sufficient component to an account of evidence. In order to secure relevance between the evidence and the hypothesis, Achinstein adds to the high-probability definition a requirement that there also be a high probability of an explanatory connection between E and H (given that E and H are true), where there is an explanatory connection between E and H if H correctly explains E, E correctly explains H, or some proposition correctly explains both of them. (Here, probabilities are not subjective degrees of belief, but are objective and have nothing to do with what any subject knows or believes). Obviously, this account avoids the birth control counterexample, precisely because there is no probability of an explanatory connection between Jones’ taking birth control and his failure to become pregnant; and it continues to avoid the swimming and the old evidence problems, for the same reason that the high probability account did on its own. Also, the account seems to yield a correct verdict in some cases. Suppose, for instance, that Jones’ wife is taking birth control pills and fails to become pregnant, but not because of her contraception, but because she is no longer fertile. On Achinstein’s view we can still say, as it seems we should, that her taking birth control pills provides evidence that she will not become pregnant, even though the pills are not the real explanation, since his view only requires there to be a high-probability of an explanatory connection, as there seems to be in this case.

One might think, though, that Achinstein has simply traded one somewhat manageable problem for two more difficult ones. For he is cashing out the evidential relation in terms of explanation and objective probability, two notions that are perhaps more in need of philosophical treatment than the evidential relation.

It should not be thought that one must employ either the positive-relevance or high-probability accounts in giving a theory of evidence. Deborah Mayo’s error-statistical account (1996) is an influential semi-probabilistic approach to evidence, that appeals to neither account. Mayo’ approach, like Achinstein’s and unlike positive relevance, is rather strong; her leading thought takes off from the Popperian intuition that “any support capable of carrying weight can only rest upon ingenious tests, undertaken with the aim of refuting our hypothesis.” Thus she proposes that E is evidence for H if and only if H passes what she calls a “severe test” with E, where H passes severe test T with E if and only if the following two conditions are satisfied:

  • E “agrees with” or “fits” H (which she leaves rather open-ended, provided that P(E/H) is not low)
  • There is a high probability that T would have produced a less fitting result than E, if H were false.

Consider a simple example. Suppose we give a patient a test T to test the hypothesis (H) that he has a disease D, and suppose (E) the test comes out positive. Suppose further that when a patient has D, T yields a positive result 95% of the time, and when the patient does not have D, T yields a negative result 99% of the time. Clearly, conditions (i) and (ii) are satisfied: E not only “fits” H, but T very probably would have yielded a less fitting (i.e. negative) result if H were false. Accordingly, since H passes a severe test T with E, E is quite strong error-statistical evidence that the patient has disease D. Intuitively, T is a very good test to use if we want to rule out that H is the case, and so a result of T that instead passes H is impressive evidence in its favor.

On the other hand, if we were to suppose that T yields false positives 95% of the time, the epistemic status of E would look quite different. While condition (i) is still satisfied, condition (ii) would not be: since the test almost as frequently produces false positives, there is a very low probability that T would have produced a less fitting result if the patient did not have D. Accordingly, T would not count as a severe test of our hypothesis H, and so E would fail to constitute error-statistical evidence for H.

Needless to say, the error-statistical approach has been adapted to cover much more complicated testing situations, and interested readers are invited to consult Mayo (1996). Another severe-testing account of evidence can be found in Giere (1983).

c. Qualitative Theories of the Evidential Relation

Not every approach to evidence has employed probabilities. In this section, we shall look at three of the better-known qualitative theories of evidence. In one way or another, these theories appeal only to deductive relationships between evidence and hypothesis.

i. Hypothetico-Deductivism

Perhaps the best-known non-quantitative approach to evidence would be hypothetico-deductivism, which is popularly thought to constitute the scientific method (see Braithwate in Achinstein (ed.), 1983 or Hempel, 1966). According to the simplest version of this approach, one invents an hypothesis and draws out its observational consequences. One then checks to see whether these consequences turn out to be true, and if so, one is said to have obtained evidence in favor of one’s hypothesis. If the consequence turns out to be false, then one has refuted one’s hypothesis. On this approach, then, evidence for an hypothesis is a true observational consequence of that hypothesis, while evidence against an hypothesis is a false observational consequence.

We consider two well-known objections to hypothetico-deductivism here and another one in §3c below. The first objection is the so-called irrelevant-conjunction objection. If an hypothesis H logically entails E, then so does the hypothesis H & H´, where H´ can be any hypothesis whatever. If E turns out to be true, then, according to this approach, it is evidence for both H and H´, which is unacceptable. The irrelevant conjunction objection shows, as we shall see again in §3c, that hypothetico-deductivism offers a much too indiscriminate an account of the evidential relationship. The second well-known objection to hypothetico-deductivism is the competing- hypothesis objection (see e.g. Mill, 1959). Suppose H entails a body of evidence E1…En, and suppose the evidence comes out true. Still, H is not the only hypothesis from which we can derive E1…En; in fact, there may be indefinitely many such hypotheses, even perhaps some that—as Mill puts it—”our minds are unfitted to conceive.” According to hypothetico-deductivism, then, E1…En would support those hypotheses equally well, and the evidence would never be sufficient to accept one hypothesis among the others. One common reply is that we ought to choose the simplest among the competing hypotheses. But first, this simply shifts the problem to defining simplicity, which has proved to be a difficult task; and second, there seems to be no reason to believe that the simpler theory is more likely to be true. These problems and others have led some philosophers to seek alternatives to hypothetico-deductivism, which we will now examine.

ii. Evidence as a Positive-Instance

One influential alternative to hypothetico-deductivism is offered by Carl Hempel (1965). On this approach, an observation-sentence E is evidence for a universal hypothesis H, just when E describes a positive instance of H—or as Hempel puts it, just when E says of the items mentioned within it what H says of all items. Intuitively, in such a case E would “instantiate” H, thus would be evidence for it. While this is hardly groundbreaking, what is novel about Hempel’s approach is that he marshaled the resources of basic predicate logic to give his account of a positive instance, thereby construing the evidential relation, like deduction, as being a syntactical relation obtaining between sentences. That is, on this approach E is evidence for H not by virtue of the specific sorts of objects E and H describe, but by virtue of the formal features of the manner in which they describe them.

For instance, suppose we are psychological researchers entertaining the “psychological hypothesis”, H, that everyone loves someone. The logical form of this hypothesis is ∀x ∃y Lxy. This simply says that, for anything x, there is some y such that x stands in relation L to y, which is a logical form shared with great many hypotheses (e.g. that everyone hates someone). Suppose further that we have observed in our psychological practice that person, a, loves himself, and that person b loves a. Again, on a purely formal level, our observation-sentence E would be “Laa & Lba“. This says that a stands in relation L to itself, and b stands in relation L to a (again, there are great many observation-sentences that would share this form). Now, to determine whether E describes an instance of H (and whether it is evidence for it), we introduce the notion of the development of H with respect to the individuals mentioned in E. Intuitively, the development of the hypothesis is simply what the hypothesis would assert if there existed only those individuals in E. Thus, purely formally, the development of H for the individuals in E is:

(Laa v Lab) & (Lbb v Lba)

With this in hand, Hempel claims that a statement is evidence for an hypothesis when it entails the hypothesis’ development. Now, since [Laa & Lba] does entail the above development, it follows that E is evidence for our hypothesis H; that is, the observation-report that person a loves himself and b loves a is evidence for the hypothesis that everyone loves someone. Since it is clear that the observation-report says of a and b what the hypothesis says of all individuals, Hempel has captured the notion of a positive instance using basic predicate logic. Moreover, since the criterion involves only the logical form of the evidence-statement and the hypothesis, any statements with those forms stands in the exact same evidential relation.

As ingenious as this may be, one obvious shortcoming of Hempel’s approach is that an observation sentence E can be evidence for an hypothesis H, only if E and H are formulated in the same vocabulary (in this case, both must employ the predicate “L”). Thus this approach cannot be used as a general theory of scientific evidence, since scientific hypotheses often employ theoretical predicates referring to unobservable entities and processes, while observation-sentences employ a strictly observational vocabulary. In the next section, we shall see that Clark Glymour—who, if you recall, raised “the problem of old evidence” against the Bayesians—developed his bootstrapping approach to evidence in part to remedy this shortcoming, while still adhering to Hempel’s basic idea that evidence is a positive instance of an hypothesis.

iii. Bootstrapping

The basic idea of Glymour’s bootstrapping theory (1975, 1980) is quite simple: to test an hypothesis in a theory consisting of several hypotheses, all of which contain theoretical terms, we can use those other hypotheses in the theory, together with observational evidence, to derive a positive instance of the hypothesis we are testing and obtain evidence for it. By repeating this process for each hypothesis in the theory, we can obtain evidence for (or against) the theory as a whole, even though the theory employs a theoretical vocabulary, while the evidence is couched in an observational one. In such a case, we are “pulling ourselves up by our own bootstraps”, in the sense that we are using certain bits of a theory to obtain evidence for other bits of the same theory, in the service of obtaining evidence for (or against) that theory as a whole.

To fill-in this abstract characterization, consider one of Glymour’s historical examples. Newton’s law of universal gravitation asserts that all bodies exert an inverse square attractive force upon one another. As evidence for this, he used Kepler’s laws of planetary motion. Yet none of Kepler’s laws contains the theoretical term “force”; they merely describe observable regularities in the planets’ orbits without offering any theoretical explanation for them. How, then, do we link the observable evidence—Kepler’s laws—to an hypothesis that contains the term “force”, so that the former can become evidentially relevant to the latter? The evidential link is supplied, of course, by other parts of Newton’s theory, namely his second law of motion relating the force on a body with the measurable quantities of mass and acceleration. Newton used the second law and the evidence of Kepler’s laws to derive instances of the law of universal gravitation for planets and their satellites. He eventually generalized this law to all bodies in the universe. Despite being the briefest sketch of Newton’s argument, this illustrates Glymour’s point: here Newton is using observational evidence and other hypotheses in a general theory under test to derive instances of—and thus evidence for—a particular hypothesis in that theory, even though the evidence and the hypothesis employ different vocabularies. This is precisely what Hempel’s instantial approach cannot achieve.

But the worry haunting Glymour’s approach, as might be expected, has surrounded the problem of circularity. A great deal of literature has been devoted by Glymour and others to deal with this and other issues (see Earman 1983).

This completes our survey of theories on the evidential relation. We have not covered all such theories, of course, but have aimed primarily at variety. In particular, we have examined theories that feature probabilistic, deductive and explanatory relationships between evidence and hypothesis. It is worth mentioning again that if Williamson is right, these theories would testify to the propositional nature of evidence.

Now that we are equipped with considerable background, in the remainder of this entry we shall consider some well-known problems and paradoxes in the theory of evidence.

3. Some Problems of Evidence

a. The Ravens Paradox

The famous ravens paradox was formulated by Carl Hempel in the very paper in which he set out his own instantial approach to evidence sketched in §2cii. The paradox arises by reflecting on the following three seemingly uncontestable assumptions.

  1. According to the first assumption, an instance provides evidence for a generalization. So, for example, if our generalization is “All ravens are black,” then an item that is both a raven and black provides at least some evidence for it. This certainly seems correct.
  2. According to the second assumption, an instance that is evidence for a generalization provides evidence for any generalization that is logically equivalent to it, that is, any sentence that is true and false in exactly the same circumstances. The idea behind this assumption is simply that logically equivalent sentences make essentially the same assertion couched in different words, and we cannot have differential confirmation of sentences based simply on the words they use. That seems correct as well.
  3. The third assumption is simply that “All ravens are black” is logically equivalent to “All non-black things are non-ravens,” since the latter is just the contra-positive of the former. This is just a matter of simple deductive logic.

The paradox, then, arises as follows. Since, for example a green book, is a non-black thing that is a non-raven, by assumption (1), it provides evidence that all non-black things are non-ravens. By assumption (2), the same green book provides evidence for any hypothesis logically equivalent to it, which, by assumption (3), means that it also provides evidence for the hypothesis that all ravens are black. In fact, most of the things in a room provide evidence for one’s ornithological hypothesis without one having to look at any birds or even leaving one’s apartment. The paradox, then, is that three ostensibly uncontestable assumptions lead to a consequence that seems intolerable.

i. Hempel’s “Solution”

Since Hempel was in the process of giving a positive-instance account of evidence when he presented the paradox, perhaps we should not be surprised that his own “solution” to the paradox was simply to accept it, arguing that its paradoxical air was a psychological illusion. The problem is that by picking some item or other in the apartment as an example, we antecedently know that it will be a non-raven, and so the outcome of the “observation” of the object seems irrelevant to the confirmation of the hypothesis. When we are then told that, in fact, the object does provide evidence for the hypothesis, this seems simply unacceptable. But suppose that all we knew was that were there is a non-black thing whose identity as a raven was still genuinely in question. In this case, finding that it is not a raven would, says Hempel, seem evidentially relevant to the hypothesis that all ravens are black. In both cases, the non-black non-raven object supplies evidence for the hypothesis, but whether this seems paradoxical or not depends upon what information we include or suppress in stating the example. Despite this, many have still found it intolerable that a green book could provide evidence that all ravens are black.

ii. A Bayesian Solution

Interestingly, Bayesians (see §2a) tend to agree with Hempel that a green book and a black raven each provide evidence for the hypothesis that all ravens are black. However, they mitigate this seemingly outlandish position by using Bayes’ theorem and the positive-relevance definition of evidence to show that one provides much stronger evidence than the other. Consider again the simple version of Bayes’ theorem, which according to Bayesians is the theorem by which we are to compute the conditional probability P(H/E):

P(H/E) = P(H) P(E/H) / P(E)

Now, it is easy to see from the theorem that as P(E) becomes larger, P(H/E) becomes smaller. If we interpret this in light of the positive relevance definition of evidence, this is to say that the more probable the evidence, the less it increases the probability of the hypothesis, and the weaker it is as a piece of evidence. Conversely, the less probable the evidence, the more it increases the probability of the hypothesis, and the stronger it is as a piece of evidence. This result is said by Bayesians to capture the allegedly intuitive notion that surprising evidence supports an hypothesis more. But note that, since there are vastly more non-black things in the universe than there are ravens, the probability of finding a non-black thing that is also a non-raven is far greater than that of finding a raven that is black. According to the theorem, then, finding a non-black, non-raven ought to increase the probability of H (that all ravens are black) much less than finding a black raven. Indeed, it ought to increase the probability of the hypothesis hardly at all, since P(E) should be close to 1. It follows that, while finding a black raven and a non-black non-raven both provide evidence for the hypothesis that all ravens are black, the latter provides much weaker evidence than the former. Indeed, since the latter affords such weak evidence, we would invariably overlook it as such, which may explain why it is so surprising to be told that (say) a green book does provide evidence that all ravens are black.

iii. An Error-Statistical Solution

Those who would regard as preposterous even the notion that a green book could supply extremely weak evidence that all ravens are black, may find some solace in an error-statistical solution to the ravens paradox. Again, to yield evidence for an hypothesis on this view, a testing procedure must severely test that hypothesis. With this in mind, it is not difficult to see that examining all non-black items in one’s apartment would fail to be a severe test of the hypothesis that all ravens are black. Again, appealing to Popper’s dictum, this would precisely not be “an ingenious test, undertaken with the aim of refuting our hypothesis.” For, while finding that all non-black items in one’s apartment are non-ravens may “agree with” the hypothesis that all ravens are black (thus satisfying Mayo’s requirement (i)), one would very probably not obtain a less fitting result from such a procedure if all ravens were not black (thus failing to satisfy requirement (ii)). That is to say, we can be certain that this test would yield the exact same results even if ravens were of a wide variety of colors.

It is important to note, though, that even finding very many black ravens may fail to provide evidence for the hypothesis on this approach. One’s testing procedure would have to ensure that one’s instances were sufficiently varied such that, if not all ravens were black, one would very probably turn up one of those non-black ravens. For example, one would at the very least have to select ravens from different locales and of different ages and sexes. In short, employing what one knows about the properties that make bird-coloration vary, one would have to do one’s best to obtain instances that would refute the hypothesis that all ravens are black in order for one’s results to count as evidence for that hypothesis.

b. The Grue Paradox

Another famous paradox haunting the positive-instance approach to evidence is Nelson Goodman’s grue paradox. Indeed, Goodman’s paradox is often thought to have put an end to purely formal approaches to evidence, such as Hempel’s, and is of tremendous historical significance.

Suppose that all emeralds examined so far have been green. Assuming again that an observed positive instance of an hypothesis provides evidence in support of it, then our observations of green emeralds provide evidence for the hypothesis that all emeralds are green. So far so good. But note that all emeralds examined so far have also been grue, where the predicate “grue” applies to all things observed before some future time t just in case they are green, or to things not so examined just in case they are blue. Again, under the assumption that an observed positive instance of an hypothesis provides evidence in support of it, our observations of grue emeralds have also supplied evidence that all emeralds are grue. Yet the two hypotheses are genuine rivals. For example, they make incompatible predictions: according to the green-hypothesis, the first emerald observed after t will be green, while according to the grue-hypothesis it will be grue (that is, blue). Thus, it seems our observations of emeralds provide no more evidence to believe that the first emerald observed after t will be green than to believe that it will grue (i.e. blue), which is intolerable.

Note that the point of the paradox is not to undermine our confidence that observations of instances can be evidence for a general proposition expressing a law or uniformity of nature. Rather, the paradox begins with that assumption, and asks the more penetrating question of which propositions are apt to express the laws or uniformities of nature, and thus which propositions are supported by observations of its instances (or which propositions are “projectable” in Goodman’s terminology). Ostensibly, both the green and the grue hypotheses are candidates here, since both assert that nature is uniform in a certain respect: one says that emeralds everywhere and throughout all time are green, while the other says they are grue. We of course believe that only the green-hypothesis is lawlike, and thus we believe only the green hypothesis can obtain support from the evidence; but the paradox demands that we give a reason for this bias.

i. Goodman’s Solution

Goodman’s own solution to his paradox is rather startling. Goodman thinks that the deep assumption generating the paradox is that an account of the evidential relationship ought to look no farther than the logical relationship between the evidence-statement and the hypothesis alone (think of Hempel’s account here). Thus, since the green and grue hypotheses both bear the exact same logical relationship to the evidence-statements—that is, since those statements simply describe observed positive instances of the hypotheses—both hypotheses are equally well supported by the evidence, which is intolerable. Hence, Goodman’s strategy involves rejecting the underlying assumption that the evidential relation is a purely logical one. While obviously the logical relation between evidence and hypothesis will be relevant to their evidential relation; there is no reason to think it is the only relevant factor. According to Goodman, our linguistic practices must also play a role. Very roughly, our observations of emeralds are evidence for the green hypothesis, and not the grue hypothesis, because “green” has been used much more frequently in hypotheses that have actually been accepted by us. On this view, the evidence supported by our observations depends in part upon how the world has heretofore been described in words. This, of course, leaves open the possibility that, had “grue” been the better-entrenched predicate, our observations would support the grue hypothesis instead.

ii. Achinstein’s Solution

Goodman’s solution seems rather shallow. It rests upon the obvious fact that we have accepted hypotheses involving the predicate “green” more frequently than those involving “grue”, without offering any rationale for our acceptance. Achinstein claims to be able to provide such a rationale with his own theory of evidence (see §2b). First, recall Achinstein requires that if E is to provide evidence for H, then the probability of H, given E, must be high. Next he requires that if observed instances are to bestow high probability on a universal hypothesis, and thus be evidence for it, the observed instances of the hypothesis must be sufficiently varied. In other words, if one’s instances are not varied, then it is hard to see how they can make the probability of a universal hypothesis high. Finally, note that grue is a disjunctive property; the predicate grue applies to two different kinds of cases, green objects observed before t or blue objects observed after t. Now, given that (1) evidence requires high probability, (2) high probability requires varied instances, and (3) grue applies to two different kinds of cases, it seems that our observed instances could never be evidence that all emeralds are grue, unless some instances of that hypothesis are of both kinds of cases. That is to say, the only way for observed emeralds to be sufficiently varied to provide evidence that all emeralds are grue, is if we examine some emeralds before t and find them to be green, and some after t and find them to be blue. Since one of the very conditions of the paradox is that we have not done so, our observations of emeralds could not provide evidence that all emeralds are grue. In general, the disjunctive nature of “grue”, and the consequent impossibility of obtaining sufficiently varied instances of grue items, explains why “grue” is not a well-entrenched predicate in our language—why we have not frequently accepted hypotheses featuring that predicate in the past. On the other hand, since “green” for us is not a disjunctive property, nothing prevents “green” from being the well-entrenched predicate that it is in our language, as Goodman observed.

c. Underdetermination of Theory by Evidence

There is no more pervasive problem in epistemology than the problem of underdetermination of theory by evidence. Consider, first, radical skepticism about the external world. Here, the skeptic proposes a seemingly far-fetched competing hypothesis to account for all the evidence that experience apparently provides about the mind-independent world. For example, perhaps I am merely a brain-in-a-vat, electrochemically stimulated by a supercomputer to have the very experiences I am having at this moment, or all the experiences I have ever had. This hypothesis is equally compatible with, and indeed entails, that I will have the very same experiential basis for belief that I would have if the world were as I have always believed it to be. Indeed, any test that I could perform to decide between the two competing hypotheses may simply be another set of experiences fed into my brain from the supercomputer. On what grounds, then, can I say that the hypothesis is “far-fetched”? Indeed, given all the evidence I will ever possess, the skeptic’s seemingly bizarre story appears just as likely to be true as my ordinary beliefs. Granted, I may prefer my ordinary beliefs out of familiarity, or even simplicity, but neither of these is a reason for believing that my ordinary beliefs are any more likely to be true; my preference would be just a baseless prejudice. Accordingly, all possible evidence I could have radically underdetermines which theory I ought to believe.

Other skeptical arguments, such as inductive skepticism and skepticism about other minds, are designed to establish the same conclusion. In the case of inductive skepticism, evidence from the past and present course of nature allegedly underdetermines the shape of the future course of nature. In the case of skepticism about other minds, evidence from what others say and do underdetermines not only what their mental life might be like, but also whether they even have a mental life. In both of these cases, the evidence stands in the exact same logical relationships to the skeptical hypotheses as they do to our favored ones. Accordingly, the evidence allegedly provides no justification whatsoever for preferring one hypothesis to the other.

But it’s not just skepticism that runs on underdetermination of theory by evidence. Indeed, the grue paradox from §3c above does so as well: none of our observations before time t favor the green hypothesis over the grue hypothesis. As we saw, the problem forced Goodman to turn to seemingly non-epistemic factors such as the sort of language we use. And there are problems of underdetermination  that are far less esoteric as well, such as the curve-fitting problem. Suppose we have a graph on which very many data points are plotted; for instance, suppose that the data points relate the pressure and volume of various samples of gas. Now, it turns out that there are infinitely many equations describing curves that can fit the evidence; in our case, this means that Boyle’s law of gases is merely one of an infinite number of equations that can fit the data. Moreover, it does not matter how many data points we add; while some curves will be ruled out with the addition of new evidence, there will always be an unending supply of equations that will fit. On what grounds, then, do we accept Boyle’s law? Once more, the idea is that the evidence itself does not determine which of the equations we ought to prefer.

In all of these cases, the evidence allegedly fails to provide any rational grounds for preferring one hypothesis over an indefinite number of competing hypotheses. To make a choice, we seem forced to prefer an hypothesis on non-evidential and therefore non-epistemic grounds. And this threatens to make a mockery of the very idea of evidence. For is evidence not supposed to help us determine what we ought to believe? If something can’t do this, with what right do we even speak of it as evidence?

These problems are far too numerous, and their solutions far too involved, for us to discuss here. We would do best to concentrate on a problem of underdetermination dealing with which the materials of the previous sections have equipped us. Hence, in the remainder of this entry, we shall concentrate on underdetermination as it relates specifically to thesis of evidential holism, or the thesis that evidence never bears on a proposition in isolation from other propositions we accept—and possibly all the propositions we accept. As we shall see, the theories of the evidential relation already on the table will not only help us set-up the problem, but also offer some solutions.

i. Underdetermination and Holism: The Duhem-Quine Problem

Uncovering the problem of holism and underdetermination is usually credited to Pierre Duhem, the late 19th and early 20th century French physicist, historian of physics, and philosopher of science. Duhem asks us to consider the hypothetico-deductive method of theory-testing, sketched in §2ci: again, from the proposition under test we derive an observable prediction; if the prediction comes out true, we are said to have evidence for the theory, while if not, we are said to have evidence against it. Yet Duhem explains that, while correct in outline, the account is much too simple: the scientist does not derive testable implications from the proposition alone, but from that proposition and “a whole group of theories accepted by him…” For example, in order to obtain any observable predictions from Newton’s laws of motion and gravitation with respect to our Solar System, we need take those laws in conjunction with a host of auxiliary hypotheses and assumed facts, such as that only gravitational forces act on planets; or assumptions about the relative masses of the planets, their satellites and the sun; or information about planetary velocities, which are, in turn, derived from instruments whose correct functioning is based on the employment of still other theories; and so on. Granted this, Duhem now asks us to suppose, as is often the case, that the prediction generated by this body of statements does not turn out true. Since no single hypothesis or theory entails the false prediction, but only a whole web of theory and alleged fact taken together, the evidence does not by itself indicate which member of that web is refuted; nature is silent with respect to where the blame lies. To put the point in starker terms, there simply is no fact of the matter with respect to which the evidence is evidence against, which is just to say that the evidence underdetermines which parts of the body are to be believed and which parts are not. This much being granted, the same should also go for evidence consistent with one’s theory: since in no case does that theory by itself entail a true observable prediction, there would simply be no fact of the matter with respect to which the evidence is evidence for. The conclusion, then, seems to be evidential holism: evidence never bears on a proposition in isolation, but only on a body of propositions taken as a whole.

Duhem thought that his problem could be solved by the “good sense” of the practicing physicist, but it was Quine who unleashed the problem of holism, by extending it beyond a theory and its auxiliary assumptions, to an entire body of statements we accept. Quine’s holism is intimately related to his rejection of the analytic-synthetic distinction in the philosophy of language. An analytic statement is one that is true solely by virtue of its meaning (such as all bachelors are unmarried), while a synthetic statement is one that is true or false by virtue of both its meaning and how things turn out in the world (such as all bachelors are less than five feet ten inches tall). Accordingly, while synthetic statements are accepted as true or rejected as false by virtue of what the world affords us in experience, analytic statements are accepted as true come what may in experience. Now Quine’s rejection of the analytic-synthetic distinction is far too involved to review here, and we only need concern ourselves with its outcome: if there is no distinction between a type of statement that is true in virtue of meaning and a type of statement that is true in virtue of how things turn out in the world, then, in principle, any statement can be accepted as true or rejected as false in the light of experience, and any statement can be held true come what may. The only constraints on what to accept or reject given the evidence of the senses are consistency with what else we accept, and pragmatic considerations such as conservatism and simplicity. Otherwise, the evidence so radically underdetermines our web of beliefs that there is an indefinite number of systems of the world that can be made to square with it. Accordingly, whichever picture of the world we choose is merely one of many, with no evidential basis to decide between them. No one puts the point better than Quine himself:

[It] becomes folly to seek a boundary between synthetic statements, which hold contingently on experience, and analytic statements, which hold come what may. Any statement can be held true come what may, if we make drastic enough adjustments elsewhere in the system… Conversely, by the same token, no statement is immune to revision. Revision of even the logical law of the excluded middle has been proposed as a means of simplifying quantum mechanics… The totality of our so-called knowledge or beliefs…is a man-made fabric which impinges on experience only along the edges. Or, to change the figure, total science is like a field of force whose boundary conditions are experience. A conflict with experience at the periphery occasions readjustments in the interior of the field. Truth-values have to be redistributed over some of our statements…But the total field is so underdetermined by its boundary conditions, experience, that there is much latitude of choice as to what statements to reevaluate in the light of any single experience. No particular experiences are linked with any particular statements in the interior of the field, except indirectly through considerations of equilibrium affecting the field as a whole….

ii. A Bootstrapping Solution

Glymour’s bootstrapping approach to evidence, if tenable, provides an ingenious response to the problem posed by Duhem and Quine, for it extracts a kernel of truth from the problem while rejecting what seems most pernicious about it. First of all, we are urged by Glymour not accept the problem, as Quine does, but instead take it as exposing the key weaknesses in the hypothetico-deductive account of evidence that generates it, namely, that such an approach makes the bearing of evidence on the theory unacceptably indiscriminate. Indeed, the irrelevant conjunction problem, as we saw in §2ci, reveals essentially the same flaw. Accordingly, far from accepting hypothetico-deductivism and the holism that comes along with it, we ought to reject the hypothetico-deductive approach on the bases that it fails to meet a crucial constraint on any acceptable theory of evidence, namely, how an observation or test can be relevant to one part of a theory while not to others.

Of course, the bootstrap approach is devised to satisfy exactly this very constraint. Again, according to this approach, we use other hypotheses in the general theory under test, together with observational data, to derive a confirming or disconfirming instance of a specific hypothesis in the theory; and we are enjoined to repeat the same process for the other individual hypotheses composing the theory itself. So while hypothetico-deductivism has the evidence entailed by a mass of theory, leaving underdetermination and holism as the inevitable consequences, bootstrapping has the evidence and a mass of theory entailing an instance of an hypothesis within it, which allows the evidence to bear specifically on a single hypothesis of interest. Hence, we can see that, contrary to holism, evidence does bear on specific parts of the theory, but, crucially, it does not do so in isolation from other parts of the theory. Thus, what is correct about holism is the notion that large parts of a theory must always be involved in theory-testing; what is not correct is to conclude from this, as Duhem and Quine do, that a piece of evidence does not bear on one part of the theory without bearing upon all of it. Of course, the plausibility of this solution can be no greater than the plausibility of the bootstrap approach as a whole, which as mentioned above, some have questioned.

iii. A Bayesian Solution

To consider a different sort of approach, subjective Bayesians (see §2a) use Bayes’ theorem, the positive/negative-relevance definition of evidence and their own subjective interpretation of probability, to illustrate how evidence can indeed single out one hypothesis among others for rejection. (Recall that, for the subjectivist, a probability is a rational subject’s degree of belief in a proposition at a given time). While these illustrations are too complicated to spell out in all their detail here, we will consider an abridged account of an illustration offered by Jon Dorling, employing a case from the 19th century physics. Our hypothesis H is Newton’s theory of motion and gravitation, and the auxiliary hypothesis A is the assumption that tidal effects do not influence secular lunar accelerations. We will suppose that H and A together entail the expected observed acceleration of the moon E´, but what is observed instead is the anomalous lunar acceleration E. Thus E tells us that H and A cannot both be true, but the problem, again, is that it seems to underdetermine which one of the two hypotheses we are to believe.

On the Bayesian view, what we need to consider are the separate effects wrought by E on the probabilities of H and A. Accordingly, the goal will be to compare P(H/E) and P(A/E), both of which can be conveniently calculated by means of Bayes’ theorem:

P(H/E) = P(H)P(E/H) / P(E)
P(A/E) = P(A)P(E/A) / P(E)

With this framework intact, we now need to assign a plausible probability distribution to the right-hand sides of these equations that would mirror the degrees of belief of a typical scientist at the time. Since the typical scientist had much confidence in both H and A, but somewhat less so in A, we can plausibly set P(H) to .9 and P(A) to .6. Next, we need to determine the so-called likelihoods, P(E/H) and P(E/A). Given some uncontroversial transformations, the details of which we will pass over here, it turns out that

P(E/H) = P(E/A & H)P(A) + P(E/~A & H)P(~A)
P(E/A) = P(E/A & H)P(H) + P(E/A & ~H)P(~H)

Now, since the obtaining of E refutes the conjunction of A&H, we already know that P(E/A&H) here would be 0. Thus the above reduce to:

P(E/H) = P(E/~A & H)P(~A)
P(E/A) = P(E/A & ~H)P(~H)

Since we already have P(A) and P(H), we can easily determine P(~A) and P(~H), which will be 0.4 and 0.1, respectively. So the object, now, is to determine P(E/~A & H) and P(E/A & ~H). It is plausible to suppose that, while scientists at the time would believe E to be highly unlikely given H and ~A (say, P(E/~A & H) = .05), it is clear that, given the wide acceptance of Newtonian theory at the time, they would take E to be virtually inexplicable if H were false. That is, the typical scientist at the time would be highly skeptical that there is a competitor to H that could account for E. Granted this, we can plausibly set P(E/A & ~H) to a very low .001. Plugging in our figures we obtain:

P(E/H) = P(E/~A & H)P(~A) = (.05) x (.4) = .02
P(E/A) = P(E/A & ~H)P(~H) = (.001) x (.1) = .0001

This gives us all the figures in the numerator of Bayes’ theorem. We still need to determine the denominator P(E). To expedite matters, we will simply suppose, as was surely the case, that our scientist believes E would be very unexpected, and will stipulate that P(E) ≈ 0.02.

Thus, we now have all of our figures to plug into the above Bayes’ theorem. Performing the calculations we find that P(H/E) ≈ .9, while P(A/E) ≈ .003. Accordingly, while the probability of Newton’s theory would be virtually unchanged given E, the probability of A given E is reduced to almost zero. But, according to the relevance definition of evidence, this means that E is very strong evidence against the auxiliary A, and not Newton’s theory. Clearly, then, it was the auxiliary A and not Newton’s theory that should have been—and was—discarded in light of E. Hence, what Bayesians offer is the machinery with which we can work out exactly how evidence bears on one hypothesis more than others. If this view is correct, the problem of holism and underdetermination would be resolved.

Some have questioned whether this constitutes a solution at all (Mayo 1996, Earman 1992). While we are certainly given probabilities that make the choice of hypothesis obvious, we are not told whether those corresponding degrees of belief would be warranted, and thus whether the choice to reject an auxiliary would be a good one. Indeed, the flexibility of subjective Bayesianism would allow a different probability distribution, according to which H rather than A would bear the brunt of the evidence. But if it would be acceptable to blame either A or H, it seems that, instead of a solution, we have a re-description of the problem—namely, which hypothesis do we reject in light of the evidence?

But for the subjective Bayesian, the objection is entirely specious. Such probability distributions would be warranted, so long as they conform to the axioms of the probability calculus. On the subjective Bayesian view, there is simply more than one rational perspective on a matter.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Achinstein, Peter (ed.) (1983) The Concept of Evidence (Oxford: Oxford University
    Press). 

    • A short collection of essential reading on the evidential relationship.
  • Achinstein, Peter (1995) “Are Empirical Evidence Claims A Priori?” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 46: 447-73.
    • Discusses the question of whether claims to have evidence for an hypothesis are themselves empirical, or known by mere calculation or logic.
  • Achinstein, Peter (2001) The Book of Evidence (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
    • An extended presentation of Achinstein’s own account of evidence, as well as applications of that account to the paradoxes of grue and the ravens, and the issue of scientific realism.
  • Achinstein, Peter (ed.) (2005) Scientific Evidence: Philosophical Theories and Applications (Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press).
    • A collection of papers by various authors addressing Achinstein’s and other views of evidence (including the error-statistical view), along with several papers on the nature of evidence in particular sciences.
  • Audi, Robert (2003) “Contemporary Modest Foundationalism” in Louis J. Pojman (ed.) The Theory of Knowledge: Classical and Contemporary Readings. (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth).
    • Uses the epistemic regress argument to support a view of foundationalism on which experiences count as evidence. Very clear and accessible.
  • Bonjour, Lawrence (1980) “Externalist Theories of Empirical Knowledge” in P.A. French, T.E. Uehling, Jr., H.K. Wettstein (eds.) Minnesota Studies in Philosophy 5: Studies in Epistemology (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press).
    • Classic critique of externalist/reliabilist theories of epistemic justification, and whether one can have justified belief without evidence of one’s reliability, or with evidence against one’s reliability.
  • Brandom, Robert (2000) “Insights and Blindspots of Reliabilism” in Articulating Reasons: An Introduction to Inferentialism (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press).
    • Among other things, questions how far the notion of reliability can separate justification from reasons for belief or evidence.
  • Carnap, Rudolf (1950) The Logical Foundations of Probability (Chicago: University of
    Chicago Press). 

    • A quantitative approach to confirmation developing Carnap’s own logical or a priori theory to probability. Highly technical but very influential.
  • Conee, Earl and Feldman, Richard (2004) Evidentialism. (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
    • Collection of papers surrounding—and defending—the thesis of evidentialism. See especially the papers “Evidentialism”, “Having Evidence”, and “Internalism Defended”.
  • Davidson, Donald (1990) “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge” in A.R. Malachowski (ed.) Reading Rorty. Critical Responses to Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature (and Beyond) (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers).
    • An argument for various coherence theories, relating essentially to Davidson’s influential views in semantics.
  • Duhem, Pierre (1954) The Aim and Structure of Physical Theory, translated by P Wiener
    (New York: Athenium). 

    • Classic work in the philosophy of science presenting the problem of underdetermination, among many other important positions.
  • Dorling, Jon (1979) “Bayesian Personalism, the Methodology of Scientific Research Programmes, and Duhem’s Problem” in Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 10: 177-87.
    • A Bayesian solution to the problem of underdetermination.
  • Earman, John (ed.) (1983) Testing Scientific Theories (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press).
    • Contains critical papers on bootstrapping. Highly technical.
  • Earman, John (1992) Bayes or Bust? (Cambridge, MA: MIT Press).
    • An assessment of Bayesian confirmation theory. Highly technical.
  • Giere, Ronald (1983) “Testing Theoretical Hypotheses” pp. 269-98 in J. Earman (ed.) Testing Scientific Theories: Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol 10 (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press).
    • Presents a severe testing approach to evidence, somewhat similar to Mayo’s.
  • Glymour, Clark (1975) “Relevant Evidence” Journal of Philosophy 72 pp. 403-420.
    • A short presentation of Glymour’s bootstrapping approach to evidence.
  • Glymour, Clark (1980) Theory and Evidence (Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press).
    • An in depth presentation of bootstrapping, as well as an evaluation of Bayesian, hypothetico-deductive and Hempel’s approaches, among others. Also presents the problem of old evidence. Technical in spots.
  • Goldman, Alvin I. (1976) “What is Justified Belief?” in G.S. Pappas (ed.) Justification and Knowledge (Dordrecht: D. Reidel).
    • A paradigm of a reliabilist theory of justified belief.
  • Goldman, Alvin I. (1986) Epistemology and Cognition. (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press).
  • Goodman, Nelson (1955) Fact, Fiction and Forecast (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press).
    • Classic presentation of the grue paradox, and Goodman’s solution.
  • Hacking, Ian (1975) The Emergence of Probability. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
    • An historical account on the development of probability that contains an account of the history of the concept of inductive evidence.
  • Hempel, Carl G. (1965) Aspects of Scientific Explanation and Other Essays in the Philosophy of Science (New York: The Free Press).
    • Contains “Studies in the Logic of Confirmation”—the less technical presentation of Hempel’s positive-instance approach—as well as several other classic papers in the epistemology of science.
  • Hempel, Carl G. (1966) Philosophy of Natural Science (Upper Saddle River, NJ: Prentice Hall).
    • A classic introduction to the philosophy of science that contains a very clear description of hypothetico-deductivism.
  • Howson, Colin and Urbach, Peter (1996) Scientific Reasoning: The Bayesian Approach,
    3rd Edition (Chicago: Open Court). 

    • A comprehensive presentation of the subjective Bayesian approach to scientific reasoning. Contains Bayesian treatments of many of the important problems in the epistemology of science, including old evidence, grue, the ravens paradox and the Duhem-Quine problem.
  • Kornblith, Hilary (1980) “Beyond Foundationalism and the Coherence Theory”, Journal of Philosophy LXXII: 597-612.
    • Author criticizes foundationalism and coherence theory, arriving at a kind of reliabilist theory of justified belief that combines aspects of both, but which also involves the notion of responsibility.
  • Kronz, Frederick (1992) “Carnap and Achinstein on Evidence” in Philosophical Studies 67: 151-167.
    • Contains a reply to Achinstein’s objections to positive relevance.
  • Mayo, Deborah (1996) Error and the Growth of Experimental Knowledge (Chicago:
    University of Chicago Press). 

    • Mayo’s error-statistical approach to scientific reasoning. Technical in spots.
  • Maher, Patrick (1996) “Subjective and Objective Confirmation” in Philosophy of Science
    63: 149-174. 

    • Contains a defense of positive-relevance against Achinstein, as well as a presentation of the authors own objective theory of confirmation, in opposition to the subjective Bayesian view.
  • McDowell, John (1996) Mind and World. (Cambridge: Harvard University Press).
    • Provocative work in which the author navigates between the pitfalls of coherentism and traditional foundationalism, arguing among other things that experience contains propositional content, and thus can stand in rational relationship to belief. Not nearly as difficult or obscure as it often made out to be.
  • Mill, John Stuart (1888) A System of Logic. 8th ed. (New York: Harper and Brothers).
    • A classic work on inductive reasoning, among other things, presenting Mill’s criticisms of hypothetico-deductivism, as well as his contribution to his famous debate with 19th century hypothetico-deductivist William Whewell.
  • Nozick, Robert (1981) Philosophical Explanations, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Contains Nozick’s “truth-tracking” account of evidence (and knowledge).
  • Pryor, James (2000) “The Skeptic and the Dogmatist”, Nous, 34, pp. 517-49.
    • Argues for a modest foundationalism about perceptual beliefs on which experience counts as evidence.
  • Quine, W. V. (1951) “Two Dogmas of Empiricism” in the Philosophical Review vol. 60.
    • Quine’s rejection of reductionism and the analytic-synthetic distinction, with its attendant holism.
  • Quine, W. V. (1992) The Pursuit of Truth. (Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
    • A compressed and accessible presentation of many of Quine’s philosophical views, with the first chapter devoted entirely to evidence.
  • Roush, Sherrilyn (2005) “Positive Relevance: a defense and challenge” in Scientific Evidence: Philosophical Theories and Applications, P. Achinstein ed. (Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press).
    • A paper co-written with Achinstein where Roush defends positive-relevance, and Achinstein attacks it once more.
  • Roush, Sherrilyn (2006) Tracking Truth: Knowledge, Evidence and Science (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
    • Updates Nozick’s truth-tracking account of evidence (and knowledge).
  • Snyder, Laura J (1994) “Is Evidence Historical?” reprinted in Philosophy of Science: The Central Issues, Curd and Cover (eds.) (New York: Norton).
    • A contribution to the debate over whether knowing about evidence prior to formulating a theory makes a difference to whether and to what extent the evidence supports the theory.
  • Stalker, Douglas, ed. (1994) Grue! The New Riddle of Induction (Princeton: Princeton University Press).
    • A large collection of papers on the grue paradox.
  • Williamson, Timothy (2000) Knowledge and its Limits (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
    • An important work in recent epistemology that contains chapters devoted especially to evidence. See especially chapters 8, 9 and 10.

Author Information

Victor DiFate
Email: vdifate1@jhu.edu
Johns Hopkins University
U. S. A.

Objects of Perception

The objects of perception are the entities we attend to when we perceive the world. Perception lies at the root of all our empirical knowledge. We may have acquired much of what we know about the world through testimony, but originally such knowledge relies on the world having been perceived by others or ourselves using our five senses: sight, hearing, touch, taste, and smell. Perception, then, is of great epistemological importance. Also, a philosopher’s account of perception is intimately related to his or her conception of the mind, so this article focuses on issues in both epistemology and the philosophy of mind. The fundamental question we shall consider concerns the objects of perception: what is it we attend to when we perceive the world? We begin with five different answers to the question, “On what does my attention focus when I look at the yellow coffee cup in front of me?”

Perceptual Realism or Direct Realism is the common sense view that tables, chairs and cups of coffee exist independently of perceivers. In addition to analyzing this theory, the following major theories of these objects are discussed in the article below:  Indirect Realism, Phenomenalism, the Intentional Theory of Perception and Disjunctivism.

Table of Contents

  1. Direct Realism
  2. Indirect Realism
    1. The Argument from Illusion
    2. Problems for Indirect Realism
      1. Dualism
      2. Adverbialism
      3. The Veil of Perception
  3. Phenomenalism
    1. Problems for Phenomenalism
  4. The Intentional Theory of Perception
    1. Clarification of the Intentional Theory of Perception
      1. Non-Conceptual Content
      2. . Phenomenology
  5. Disjunctive Accounts of Perception
    1. Disjunctivism and Cognitive Externalism
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Direct Realism

Perceptual realism is the common sense view that tables, chairs and cups of coffee exist independently of perceivers. Direct realists also claim that it is with such objects that we directly engage. The objects of perception include such familiar items as paper clips, suns and olive oil tins. It is these things themselves that we see, smell, touch, taste and listen to. There are, however, two versions of direct realism: naïve direct realism and scientific direct realism. They differ in the properties they claim the objects of perception possess when they are not being perceived. Naïve realism claims that such objects continue to have all the properties that we usually perceive them to have, properties such as yellowness, warmth, and mass. Scientific realism, however, claims that some of the properties an object is perceived as having are dependent on the perceiver, and that unperceived objects should not be conceived as retaining them. Such a stance has a long history:

By convention sweet and by convention bitter, by convention hot, by convention cold, by convention colour; in reality atoms and void. [Democritus, c. 460-370 BCE, quoted by Sextus Empiricus in Barnes, 1987, pp. 252-253.]

Scientific direct realism is often discussed in terms of Locke’s distinction between primary and secondary qualities. The Primary qualities of an object are those whose existence is independent of the existence of a perceiver. Locke’s inventory of primary qualities included shape, size, position, number, motion-or-rest and solidity, and science claims to be completing this inventory by positing such properties as charge, spin and mass. The secondary qualities of objects, however, are those properties that do depend on the existence of a perceiver. They can either be seen as properties that are not actually possessed by the objects themselves, or, as dispositional properties, properties that objects only have when considered in relation to their perceivers. On the former interpretation, the cup itself is not yellow, but the physical composition of its surface, and the particular way this surface reflects light rays into our eyes, causes in us the experience of seeing yellow. And, on the latter interpretation, for an object to be yellow is for it to be disposed to produce experiences of yellow in perceivers. Locke is usually seen as being committed to this latter type of account:

Such qualities which in truth are nothing in the objects themselves, but powers to produce various sensations in us by their primary qualities. [Locke, 1690, 2.8.10]

The secondary qualities, then, comprise such properties as color, smell and felt texture.

We have seen that for the naïve realist, objects that are not actually being perceived continue to have all the properties we normally perceive them as having. For the scientific realist, however, only some of the properties we perceive continue to be possessed by objects when there are no perceivers around, these being their primary qualities.

The distinction between primary and secondary qualities is controversial in various ways, but that need not concern us here. What we should be clear on, however, is that the key feature of both naïve and scientific direct realism is that we directly attend to objects whose existence is independent of perceivers, objects that are out there in the world. The following section questions this whole approach.

2. Indirect Realism

The indirect realist agrees that the coffee cup exists independently of me. However, through perception I do not directly engage with this cup; there is a perceptual intermediary that comes between it and me. Ordinarily I see myself via an image in a mirror, or a football match via an image on the TV screen. The indirect realist claim is that all perception is mediated in something like this way. When looking at an everyday object it is not that object that we directly see, but rather, a perceptual intermediary. This intermediary has been given various names, depending on the particular version of indirect realism in question, including “sense datum, ” “sensum,” “idea,” “sensibilium,” “percept” and “appearance.” We shall use the term “sense datum” and the plural “sense data.” Sense data are mental objects that possess the properties that we take the objects in the world to have. They are usually considered to have two rather than three dimensions. For the indirect realist, then, the coffee cup on my desk causes in my mind the presence of a two-dimensional yellow sense datum, and it is this object that I directly perceive. Consequently, I only indirectly perceive the coffee cup, that is, I can be said to perceive it in virtue of the awareness I have of the sense data that it has caused in my mind. These latter entities, then, must be perceived with some kind of inner analog of vision. We shall first look at some weak arguments for this stance. After dismissing these we shall turn to the Argument From Illusion. This is a highly influential argument that many see as persuasive. In addition to supporting indirect realism, the other three theories of perception—phenomenalism, intentionalism and disjunctivism can be seen as responses to it.

As well as looking at my coffee cup, I can look out of my window and see the stars in the night sky. However, it is a fact (one that can amaze on first discovery) that the star at which I am currently looking may have ceased to exist. The pinpoint of light that I see has taken years to reach me, and in that time the star may have turned supernova. How can I, then, be directly attending to that star when it is no longer there? What must be happening is that the light rays that originated from that star have caused in me the presence of a perceptual intermediary, an intermediary that is still present in my mind, and thus, an intermediary to which I can still attend.

This argument can be applied not just to far distant objects, but to everything we perceive. Light also takes time to travel from the cup to my eyes. Therefore, I am now perceiving the cup as it was a fraction of a millisecond ago. The steam I see rising from it is actually further from the cup than it now appears to me. So again, it cannot be the steam that I directly see since I am not seeing it in the state that it is now in. It must, therefore, be a perceptual intermediary that I perceive.

This, however, is not a persuasive line of argument. One should reject the assumption that the object of perception has to exist at the moment we become perceptually aware of that object. Perception is a causally mediated process, and causation takes time. Because of this, at the time when perceptual processing is complete, the properties of perceived objects may be distinct from those possessed by the object at the time when their causal engagement with our perceptual apparatus began. As said, in extreme cases the objects of perception may no longer exist at the moment when the causal process of perception is complete. One should, therefore, accept that all the events we perceive are to some extent in the past.

The fact that perception is a complex causal process motivates some to offer another weak argument for the indirect realist position. There are many neurophysiological features and physiological entities such as retinal images that are involved in perception. Some conclude that I do not directly see the cup; I see it via such entities, and the indirect realist should take these to be his perceptual intermediaries. The correct response here is to agree (as one must) that such physiological items are indeed intermediaries in the process of perception. They are, however, intermediaries in a different sense. The indirect realist claims that we perceive his intermediaries — we attend to them — just as we do to our image in the mirror. His intermediaries are perceptually accessible. This, however, is plainly not true of the physiological components of the perceptual process. They are not, therefore, perceptual intermediaries in the correct sense. They are simply part of the causal mechanism that enables us to perceptually engage with objects, both those around us, and those in the far distance. So far, then, we do not have any reason to give up direct realism. Many, however, have seen the following argument as providing such a reason.

a. The Argument from Illusion

Illusions occur when the world is not how we perceive it to be. When a stick is partially submerged in water, it looks bent when in fact it is straight. From most angles plates look oval rather than round. (We still, of course, believe that the plate is circular and that the stick is straight because of what we know about perspective and refraction; but these objects can still look bent and elliptical if we resist interpreting what we see with respect to such knowledge.) As well as being prey to illusions, we can also have hallucinations in which there is nothing actually there to perceive at all. It is both of these phenomena that are seen to drive the following key argument for indirect realism.

I’ll partly submerge a pencil in my glass of water (the one that is next to my yellow coffee cup). The pencil appears bent. There is, then, a bent shape in my visual field. I know, however, that the pencil is not really bent. (Or, if this were a case of hallucination rather than illusion, there would not be a pencil there at all.) The bent shape of which I am aware, therefore, cannot be the real pencil in the world. Perhaps, then, it is a physical object on the surface of my cornea, or one floating inside my eyeball (it is possible to see such objects). Empirical evidence, however, has shown that there are no such objects that correlate with our perceptual experiences. So, if the bent shape is not a physical object, it must be something mental. As we have seen, these mental items have been coined “sense data”, and it must be these that we attend to in cases of illusion and hallucination.

Let us now turn to the veridical case. Cases of veridical perception are qualitatively identical to those of illusion or hallucination, and so there must be something in common between the normal case and these non-veridical ones. (This is a key assumption to which we shall return.) The conclusion we should draw, then, is that the common factor between the veridical and the non-veridical cases of perception is the presence of a sense datum. Therefore, in cases of veridical perception it is also sense data with which we perceptually engage. According to the orthodox interpretation, Locke can be seen as holding such a theory: “The mind…perceives nothing but its own ideas” [Locke, 1690, 4.4.3]. (Ideas, of course, being mental components akin to sense data.) And, this kind of theory has continued to have a distinguished following, its adherents include Bertrand Russell, Alfred J. Ayer and Frank Jackson (the latter, however, has recently abandoned this view).

There are various problems with this argument and we shall look at some of these in the following section. However, whether or not the argument is successful, there is no doubt that it has been highly influential. The theories of perception covered in the rest of this article are in part driven by the argument from illusion. Phenomenalism (section 3) accepts the existence of sense data, but denies that they play the role of perceptual intermediaries between the world and us. There is no world on the other side of our sense data; or, we should conceive of the material world as a construction of our sense data. Intentionalism (section 4) agrees that there is indeed something in common between the veridical and the non-veridical cases. However, this common factor should not be seen as an object, but rather, as intentional content. And finally, disjunctivism (section 5) undercuts the argument from illusion by rejecting the assumption that there must be something in common between the veridical and non-veridical cases. We will discuss these theories below, but first we shall consider the problems with the very idea of sense data, and with the argument from illusion itself.

b. Problems for Indirect Realism

i. Dualism

Many see a problem with respect to the metaphysics of sense data. Sense data are seen as inner objects, objects that among other things are colored. Such entities, however, are incompatible with a materialist view of the mind. When I look at the coffee cup there is not a material candidate for the yellow object at which I am looking. Crudely: there is nothing in the brain that is yellow. Sense data, then, do not seem to be acceptable on a materialist account of the mind, and thus, the yellow object that I am now perceiving must be located not in the material world but in the immaterial mind. Indirect realism is committed to a dualist picture within which there is an ontology of non-physical objects alongside that of the physical. There are, however, two major difficulties with dualism. These difficulties are outlined below.

The first and greatest problem for the dualist concerns explaining the interaction between mind and body. Remember, the indirect realist accepts that there is a world independent of our experience, and, in veridical cases of perception it is this world that somehow causes sense data to be manifest in our minds. How, though, can causal interactions with the world bring about the existence of such non-physical items, and how can such items be involved in causing physical actions, as they appear to be? If I have a desire for caffeine, then my perception of the coffee cup causes me to reach out for that cup. A non-physical sense datum causes the physical movement of my arm. Such causal relations seem to be counter to the laws of physics. The physical view of nature aims to be complete and closed: for every physical event there is a physical cause. Here, though, the cause of my reaching out for the cup is in part non-physical, and thus, the closure of physics is threatened. The only way to maintain both physical closure and the causal efficacy of the mental is to claim that there is overdetermination, i.e. that my reaching for the cup has two causes, one involving sense data, and one involving purely physical phenomena, either of which is in itself sufficient to bring about that action. This line, however, is difficult to accept since according to such an account my perception of the cup is incidental to my action: I would have reached for the cup even if I was not consciously aware that it was there. There are, then, problems in reconciling a non-physical conception of sense data with certain widely held views concerning causation.

A dualistically conceived mind appears to be paradoxical in the same way as fictional ghosts are: ghosts can pass through walls, yet they do not fall through the floor; they can wield axes yet swords pass straight through them. Similarly, the mind is conceived as both distinct from the physical world, and also causally efficacious within it, and it is not clear how the mind can coherently possess both features. Descartes himself admitted that he was stumped by the problem of how to account for the interaction between physical entities and the mental realm:

It does not seem to me that the human mind is capable of conceiving quite distinctly and at the same time both the distinction between mind and body, and their union; because to do so, it is necessary to conceive them as a single thing, and at the same time to conceive them as two things, which is self-contradictory. [Descartes, 1970, 142]

A second problem associated with the non-physical nature of sense data is that concerning their spatial location. Our perception presents objects as lying in spatial relations with respect to each other. According to the indirect realist, the objects of perception are sense data, and thus, our perceptual experience presents one sense datum as being in front of another, and that green one to the left of that red one: “The relative positions of physical objects in physical space must more or less correspond to the relative positions of sense data in our private spaces” [Russell, 1912, p. 15]. But how can this be so? On the Cartesian conception of dualism, the non-physical does not have spatial dimensions, and so how can one component of this realm be seen as in front of another? And, how can such non-physical entities be describable in the spatial way we describe physical bodies? How can a non-physical sense datum be round or square? The non-physical nature of sense data seems to threaten the coherence of an indirect realist description of sensory experience. We can say that we see the round green object as just to the left of the square red one if we are talking about spatially located objects in the world, but not if we are talking about non-physical mental items, items for which the idea of spatial location has no application.

ii. Adverbialism

Some see the argument from illusion as begging the question. It is simply assumed, without argument, that in the non-veridical case I am aware of some thing that has the property that the stick appears to me to have. It is assumed that some object must be bent. One can, however, reject this assumption: I only seem to see a bent pencil; there is nothing there in the world or in my mind that is actually bent. Only if you already countenance such entities as sense data will you take the step from something appears F to you to there is an object that really is F. Such an objection to indirect realism is forwarded by adverbialists. We can illustrate their claim by turning to other everyday linguistic constructions, examples in which such ontological assumptions are not made. “David Beckham has a beautiful free kick” does not imply that he is the possessor of a certain kind of object — a kick — something that he could perhaps give away or sell in the way that he can his beautiful car. Rather, we take this to mean that he takes free kicks beautifully. When one gives a mean-eye, one looks meanly at somebody else; one does not offer them an actual eye of some kind. Similarly, then, when one perceives yellow one is sensing in a yellow manner, or yellowly. Our perception should be described in terms of adverbial modifications of the various verbs characteristic of perception, rather than in terms of objects to which our perceptual acts are directed. As I sip my drink, I see brownly and smell bitterly; I do not attend to brown and bitter objects, the inner analogues of the properties of the cheap coffee below my nose. As Wittgenstein often took great pains to point out, many philosophical problems are simply the result of grammatical confusion, or, as Lowe puts it, “an inconvenient legacy of Indo-European languages” [Lowe, 1995, p. 45]. In describing our perceptual experiences we are not describing the visual and olfactory properties of mental items; but rather, we are talking about the manner in which we experience the external world. Thus, if one can give an account of what it is to experience in a brown and bitter manner, then one can account for perception without relying upon sense data. This, we shall see below, the intentionalist and the disjunctivist attempt to do.

iii. The Veil of Perception

Indirect realism invokes the veil of perception. All we actually perceive is the veil that covers the world, a veil that consists of our sense data. What, then, justifies our belief that there is a world beyond that veil? In drawing the focus of our perception away from the world and onto inner items, we are threatened by wholesale skepticism. Since we can only directly perceive our sense data, all our beliefs about the external world beyond may be false. There may not actually be any coffee cups or olive oil tins in the world, merely sense data in my mind. However, for this to be a strong objection to indirect realism, it would have to be the case that direct realism was in a better position with respect to skepticism, but it is not clear that this is so. The direct realist does not claim that his perceptions are immune to error, simply that when one correctly perceives the world, one does so directly and not via an intermediary. Thus, things may not always be the way that they appear to be, and therefore, there is (arguably) room for the sceptic to question one-by-one the veracity of all our perceptual beliefs.

3. Phenomenalism

Some have embraced the skepticism suggested by indirect realism and accepted the anti-realist position that there is no world independent of the perceiver. Two strategies that take this line are idealism and phenomenalism. Berkeley (1710) is an idealist. For him, physical objects consist in collections of ideas or, what have later come to be called, “sense data.” It is only objects conceived of in this way of which we can have knowledge. Sense data, however, cannot exist if they are not being perceived, and so, ‘physical’ objects conceived of in this way are also dependent on perceivers. For Berkeley, therefore, the universe simply consists in minds and the sense data that they perceive. There is only immaterial substance.

A consequence of such an account would seem to be that when we do not perceive the world it does not exist; there are gaps in the existence of objects. Berkeley, however, attempts to avoid this conclusion by claiming that God “fills the gaps.” God perceives the objects that are not perceived by us, and thus, sustains their existence; an existence, though, that subsists merely in the realm of ideas or sense data.

[A]ll the furniture of the earth….have not any subsistence without a mind…their being is to be perceived or known,….consequently, so long as they are not actually perceived by me or do not exist in my mind or that of any other created spirit, they must either have no existence at all or else subsist in the mind of some external spirit…. it being perfectly unintelligible….to attribute to any single part of them an existence independent of a spirit. [Berkeley, 1710, part 1, para. 6]

Such a position is of course highly problematic, but perhaps surprisingly, some of its idealistic elements were widely adopted in the early twentieth century by a group of philosophers called ‘phenomenalists.’

Idealists conceive of the world in terms of our actual experiences (and, for Berkeley, those of God). Phenomenalists hold a related position: for them, propositions about the physical world should be seen as propositions about our possible experiences. Or, as Mill (1867) claims, material objects are nothing but “permanent possibilities of sensation.” Phenomenalism is classically taken as a conceptual thesis: statements about physical objects have the same meaning as statements describing our sense data.

The meaning of any statement which refers to a material thing may be fully conveyed in statements which refer solely to sense-data or the sensible appearance of things. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 152. Note, however, that this is not Chisholm’s own view]

Phenomenalism, therefore, avoids the problem of gaps in a distinct way. Physical objects can exist unperceived since there is the continued possibility of experience. To say that the paper clip is in my drawer is to say that I would see it on opening that drawer. The world, then, is described in terms of our current sense data, and in terms of conditionals that detail which sense data we would encounter in counterfactual and future situations. We must, however, be careful to note the crucial difference between the realist and anti-realist readings of such conditionals. Realism, be it direct or indirect, has an account of why such a conditional holds: I will have the experience of perceiving a paper clip since there exists independent of my mind a real paper clip in the drawer. Phenomenalists, however, do not ground their conditionals in this way since there is no world independent of our (possible) experiences. To say that the paper clip is in my drawer, is simply to say that the flux of sense data characteristic of the experience of  opening a drawer will be followed by the experience of perceiving the silvery-colored sense data that constitutes a perception of a paper clip. There is no mention here of an independent world; such conditionals are only described in terms of the content of one’s experiences.

To make the phenomenalist claim clear, it is useful to look at the distinction between dispositional and categorical properties. Conditionals can be used to describe dispositional properties such as solubility: that lump of sugar is soluble since it will dissolve if I put it in my cup of coffee. Dispositional properties, however, usually have a categorical grounding. Sugar is soluble because of its chemical structure. The conditionals of the phenomenalist, however, should be taken as describing dispositions that do not have such a grounding. The regularities in our experience that they pick out do not have a categorical basis, unlike the psychological regularities of the realist that are grounded in our engagement with the existent external world. The experiential regularities of the phenomenalist are brute; nothing further can be said about why they hold.

a. Problems for Phenomenalism

For many, the idealistic nature of phenomenalism is unpalatable. A consequence of phenomenalism would seem to be that if there were no minds then there would be no world. This is so since ‘physical’ objects are simply constructs of our (possible) experience. Let us also consider the thoughts of others. I seem to be able to interpret what you are thinking by considering your behavior, by watching your actions and listening to your utterances. Your behavior, however, like the rest of the material world, simply consists of my sense data and the counterfactual relations of these mental items. Thus, phenomenalism invokes a solipsistic picture in which it is my sense data alone that constitute the world. A phenomenalist sitting here reading this article from the screen must claim that the computer monitor simply consists in the possibility of sensations that their own physical body (also a part of the material world) also has this nature, and that the people which can be seen in the street outside are similarly constructs of the phenomenalist’s own sense data. Phenomenalism is a very radical stance to take.

Also, even for those who do not have qualms about adopting such an idealistic and solipsistic stance, there are arguments which suggest that phenomenalism cannot complete the project it sets itself. A key argument against phenomenalism is the argument from perceptual relativity. Chisholm (1948) argues that one cannot provide translations of statements about physical objects in terms of statements about sense data. For a phenomenalist, the statement that there is an old green olive oil tin to my right means that the experience of reaching to the right would, on encountering the jagged rim, be followed by a sharp sensation; and that the sensation of turning my head would be followed by the presence of green sense data in my visual field. However, such fluxes of experience need not occur in this way. With gloves on, I would not feel such a sharp sensation; and, I may be color blind or the lights may be out and thus I may not experience green sense data. The sensations I have depend on various facts about me (the perceiver) and my environment. There are no lawlike conditional statements that describe the relation between sensations considered in isolation from physical aspects of the perceiver and of the world.

To calculate the appearances with complete success, it is necessary to know both the thing perceived and the (subjective and objective) observation conditions, for it is the thing perceived and the observation conditions working jointly which determine what is to appear. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 513]

A phenomenalist cannot account for such observation conditions since he is not permitted to talk of the physical states of the perceiver or those of the environment. He can only talk of sense data and the relations between them. Therefore, according to Chisholm, there are no phenomenalist translations to be had, and thus, phenomenalism fails.

4. The Intentional Theory of Perception

The last two positions at which we shall look deny that sense data are involved in perception. To do this they must find alternative responses to the argument from illusion, and they must provide a story that explains how we are in direct contact with the world.

Intentionalists emphasize parallels between perceptions and beliefs. Beliefs represent the world: I now have a belief about the pencil tin (the one that used to contain olive oil), and this belief represents that particular part of the world as being green. Beliefs, then, possess aboutness or what philosophers of mind call “intentionality.” Intentionality is considered to be an essential feature of the mind, and it describes the property that certain mental states have of representing — or, being about — certain aspects of the world. The aspects of the world that a belief is about can be specified in terms of its intentional content. The intentional content of my current belief is that tin is green. The intentionalist claim is that perceptions are also representational states (intentionalism is sometimes called representationalism). I can, then, believe that that tin is green, and I can also perceive that it is. You are about to perceive that the first word of the next paragraph is “Let.” Your perception is intentional: it is about a word on the screen; and, its content is that the next word is “Let.”

Let us see how the intentionalist reacts to the argument from illusion. The key claim will be that representational states can be in error. I can have false beliefs: I can believe that my cup is full when it is not; and I can have beliefs about non-existent entities: I can believe that the Tooth Fairy visited me last night. Such beliefs are analogous to the non-veridical perceptual cases of illusion and hallucination. In both belief and perception, the world is represented to be a certain way that it is not. And, crucially, the intentionalist has an account of what such veridical and non-veridical cases have in common: their intentional content. My perception has the representational content, there is a bent pencil there, whether or not there really is such a pencil in the world (I might have been duped and an actual bent pencil placed in the glass). In the veridical case this content correctly represents the world; in the non-veridical case it does not. Intentionalists, therefore, agree with sense datum theorists that there is an aspect of perception that is shared by the veridical and the non-veridical cases. This shared component, however, is not the presence of a perceptual object, but rather, that of a certain intentional content. Therefore, both intentionalists and sense datum theorists can be seen as providing representational accounts of perception: intentional content and the sense data of the indirect realist represent the state of the independent external world. Intentionalists, however, have representation without an ontological commitment to mental objects.

Intentionalism is driven by current themes in the philosophy of mind. Many in that field are optimistic about providing a broadly scientific, causal account of representation and intentionality. If one could provide such an account then a naturalistically acceptable theory of perception should be seen to drop out of this research. To explain perception one does not have to posit non-physical sense data; rather, one could simply use one’s naturalistic account of intentional content, since, according to intentionalists, the important features of perception are captured by this notion.

a. Clarification of the Intentional Theory of Perception

i. Non-Conceptual Content

There is a debate concerning the nature of the representational content relevant to perception. We are talking of content, so all are agreed that such content is evaluable as correct or incorrect. The question of whether the world is as it is represented to be is always pertinent. The debate, however, concerns whether all such representational content must be conceptually structured (see McDowell, 1994, lecture 3); or, whether some of the representational content involved in perception is non-conceptual (see Peacocke, 1992, chapter 3). (A concept is a constituent of thought that is apt for being the content of a judgment or a belief.) Two arguments that suggest the existence of non-conceptual content are those concerning the fine-grain of experience and the experience of animals.

It seems implausible that I have a distinct concept for every shade of brown that I perceive in the pair of battered old corduroy trousers that I am now wearing, or concepts corresponding to all the nuances of my neighbor’s distorted music that I am currently hearing through my study wall. Our experience appears to be more finely grained than our conceptual repertoire. If one is an intentionalist, then one could invoke representational content that is not conceptual to account for the richness of one’s experience. Also, many are unwilling to ascribe conceptual capacities to animals (at least if one goes far enough down the phylogenetic ladder). However, those same people are often less restrictive with their ascription of experiential properties. They would like to allow animals to have experiences and perception without a conceptual framework within which to structure them. If one is an intentionalist, then non-conceptual content could also be invoked to account for animal perception.

ii. Phenomenology

There are problems associated with accounting for the phenomenological features of perception. My experience consists in more than simply representing that the world is a certain way; it is also the case that the way I acquire representations strikes my consciousness distinctively. Right now there is a faint sound of a road drill syncopating with the reverse warning beep of a supermarket delivery truck; the yellow cup in front of me is slowly fading to brown as a cloud passes overhead; and the smell of coffee is struggling to get past my persistent cold and the pungency of my throat lozenges. All of this is part of my perceptual experience, and for the intentionalist, this experience consists in such representational content as, the truck is emitting a beep, and, my throat lozenge is pungent. There is also, however, something “it is like” to be having such representations (see Nagel, 1974). Our experience has a phenomenological dimension, a dimension that you are probably currently imagining. The shrill beep goes right though me, and the lozenge is so strong that although it pervades my consciousness, I somehow also feel sharper, clearer, more finely tuned to the quality of the air that I am breathing. The intentionalist, therefore, must also account for these phenomenological properties of perception. I shall look at two responses here, one that develops the intentionalist line in order to account for these features of perception, and one that takes such considerations to show that a pure intentionalist account is untenable.

One route that the intentionalist could take is to identify the phenomenological aspects of our experience with the representational. Naturalistically minded philosophers attempt to provide a causal account that explains how our mental states, experiences and perceptions have the intentional content that they do. One could, then, claim that the causal processes that ground intentional content also have a phenomenological aspect. It is the very same state that has both representational content and phenomenological features.

There are, however, problems associated with such a claim. Some see an unbridgeable gap between physical and phenomenological phenomena (see Levine, 1983). Any account couched in terms of the broadly physical properties of the brain cannot hope to capture the conscious, phenomenological dimension of thought and perception.

[There is] the feeling of an unbridgeable gulf between consciousness and brain process…This idea of a difference in kind is accompanied by slight giddiness. (Wittgenstein, 1953, § 412)

Others, however, see this explanatory gap as illusory (see Tye, 2002). Here, though, is not the place to pursue this debate.

The second broad response to the phenomenology of experience is to claim that representational properties alone cannot account for perception, and thus, one should reject the intentionalist project. If one is to account for what it is like to perceive the world, then one also requires sensational properties (properties distinct from those relevant to representation). Peacocke (1988) supports this line. He suggests examples in which there are aspects of our experience that have the same representational content, yet which differ in their phenomenological character. He therefore claims that representational content alone cannot account for phenomenology. Ahead of you on the motorway are two trucks, one just ahead and one near the horizon. You represent them as being of the same size and as moving at the same speed. There is, however, a sense in which the nearer one seems bigger to you — it takes up more of your visual field — and, it moves across your visual field at a faster rate. These features of your experience, then, are not captured in terms of representational content. Peacocke’s claim, therefore, is that “concepts of sensation are indispensable to the description of the nature of any experience” [Peacocke, 1983, p. 4].

Advocates of Peacocke’s line often favor the existence of qualia (singular: quale). These are seen (by some) as the non-representational, phenomenological properties of experience. One must, however, be very careful when reading the literature concerning qualia since the term is sometimes used in other ways. Others see it as merely referring to the phenomenological aspects of our experience (whether or not these can be captured in representational terms). In this sense, qualia are uncontroversial; they merely commit one to the claim that our experience is conscious. Others, notably Dennett (1991, chapter 12), take qualia to be essentially private, and our knowledge of them to be incorrigible. Conceived thus, he denies that there are such entities.

We have, then, been considering whether the phenomenological aspects of perception can be integrated into an intentionalist account. In summary, one can either identify these phenomenological features with the causal processes that are constitutive of the representational content of perception, or one can take such features to demand that an account of perception must include properties other than those that are representational.

5. Disjunctive Accounts of Perception

Finally we have a rather different approach. Disjunctivism denies the key assumption that there must be something in common between veridical and non-veridical cases of perception, an assumption that is accepted by all the positions above, and an assumption that drives the argument from illusion. For the disjunctivist, these cases certainly seem to be the same, but they are, however, distinct. This is because in veridical perception the world is presented to us. The world is not just represented as being a certain way, as for the intentionalist; but rather, the world partly constitutes one’s perceptual state. Thus, one’s perceptual state when hallucinating is entirely distinct from one’s perceptual state when actually attending to the world. To be in the state that I am in when I veridically perceive a green tin, there really has to be something there that is green. This, remember, is also one of the commitments of the sense datum theorist; but for the disjunctivist, the green item is in the world, it is not an internal mental object.

This position is called “disjunctivism” because when I seem to see a green tin, I am either perceiving a green tin or it is as if there is a green tin in front of me (a disjunction of perceptual states). I am not in a perceptual state that is common to both types of experience.

Of facts to the effect that things seem thus and so to one, we might say, some are cases of things being thus and so within the reach of one’s subjective access to the external world, whereas others are mere appearances. [McDowell, 1986, p. 241]

Disjunctivism can avoid the argument from illusion since it does not accept that veridical and non-veridical perceptual states are in any way the same (they only seem to be). We do not, therefore, have to posit a common factor, either in the form of a sense datum, or an intentional content. There is, then, a key difference between the strategies of the intentionalist and the disjunctivist: intentionalists answer the argument from illusion by claiming that veridical and non-veridical perceptions have a type of representational state in common, whereas disjunctivists undercut the argument by claiming that there is no need to posit such a common factor.

Proponents of disjunctivism see their position as upholding certain common sense assumptions about the nature of perception. It is claimed that both sense datum theorists and intentionalists do not account for the idea that it is the qualities of the tin in front of me of which I am directly conscious. This is because for the former it is the qualities of a mental sense datum that are the focus of my consciousness; and for both, the content of one’s experience could be just the same even if there was not a tin there and one was hallucinating. Such accounts, then, do not capture the intuition that the nature of my current experience is constituted by my consciousness of the properties of the tin at which I am looking.

However, in any particular case the disjunctivist must accept that he cannot tell which disjunct holds. When prey to illusion or hallucination, it can seem to you as if you are really perceiving the actual state of the world, and thus, it seems to you that you are in the same perceptual state that you would be in if the world was really how you perceive it to be. A consequence of disjunctivism, then, is that one can be not only deluded about the state of the world, but also about the state of one’s own mind. When one is unknowingly prey to illusion or hallucination, one is in fact in an entirely distinct perceptual state from the state that one takes oneself to be in. This is an anti-Cartesian position since:

In a fully Cartesian picture, the inner life takes place in an autonomous realm, transparent to the introspective awareness of its subject. [McDowell, 1986, p.236]

[The mind is] a realm of reality in which samenesses and differences are exhaustively determined by how things seem to the subject, and hence which are knowable through and through by exercising one’s capacity to know how things seem to one. [Ibid. P.249]

a. Disjunctivism and Cognitive Externalism

A consequence of disjunctivism is that two physically identical brains can be in distinct perceptual states. Imagine there is a demon or a very clever scientist who uses his supernatural powers or hi-tech wizardry to simultaneously remove the green tin from existence, while stimulating my brain in the way that it would have continued to be stimulated if the green tin had remained there on my desk. If this were so, experientially everything would appear to me to be the same as it is now, and, ex hypothesi, the flux of my brain states would also be the same as that which is currently occurring as I now look at the tin. According to the disjunctivist, however, such demonic intervention will induce in me an entirely distinct perceptual state, that of a hallucinatory rather than a veridical perception. Many cannot accept this consequence of disjunctivism. They claim that the mind must supervene on the brain, i.e. that if the physical states of two brains are identical, then so too must be the thoughts, experiences, and perceptions manifest in those brains.

However, the disjunctivist conclusion can be embraced by those who accept cognitive externalism. For such externalists, the world plays a constitutive role in determining the content of our mental states: “Cognitive space incorporates the relevant portion of the ‘external’ world” [McDowell, 1986, p. 258]. The contents of the brain alone do not determine the nature of our thoughts and experiences. There is, however, some notion of supervenience maintained in that the mind supervenes on the brain together with its causal links to the environment: if there are two identical brains causally connected to the same features of their environment, then the mental states manifest in those brains must also be identical.

Various arguments have been forwarded for this externalist position; most notable is Putnam’s Twin Earth thought experiment (1975). We can imagine two physically identical characters, Oscar and Toscar; Oscar lives here and Toscar lives on Twin Earth, a superficially identical planet over the other side of the universe. Oscar and Toscar are molecule for molecule alike, right down to the structure of their brains; and, they both have beliefs about the clear stuff that lies in puddles and rains from the sky. On Twin Earth, however, this clear refreshing liquid is in fact XYZ and not H20. Toscar, then, is thinking about different stuff to Oscar, and therefore, the thoughts of Oscar and Toscar have different content, even though we have specified that everything inside their heads is the same. The externalist stance can be summarized thus: “Thought content ain’t in the head” (to hijack Putnam’s phrase). Disjunctivists hold a parallel claim: since it is the state of the world that determines the content of one’s perceptual state, hallucinations have nothing perceptually in common with veridical perceptions even though all could be the same inside one’s head. Therefore, one must accept such externalist thinking if one is to take on the disjunctivist position.

We have, then, come to the end of our survey and we have found that perception is the focus of rich philosophical debate. We have seen that it is the point at which the philosophy of mind, epistemology and metaphysics meet. Therefore, one’s account of the objects of perception will be characteristic, not only of one’s views on how we acquire knowledge about the world, but also, of one’s philosophical perspective on such wider issues as those concerning the constitution of the mind, the constitution of the world, and crucially, how the former engages with the latter.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Barnes, J., Early Greek Philosophy, Penguin, London, 1987.
  • Dennett, D., Consciousness Explained, Little, Brown and Company, New York, 1991.
  • Descartes, R., Descartes: Philosophical Letters, Trans. / ed. A. Kenny, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1970. Levine, J., “Materialism and Qualia: The Explanatory Gap” in Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 64, pp. 354-361, 1983.
  • Locke, J., An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, ed. P. H. Nidditch, 1975, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1690.
  • Lowe, E. J., Locke on Human Understanding, Routledge, London, 1995.
  • McDowell, J., “Singular Thought and the Extent of Inner Space” in Mind, Knowledge and Reality (1998) Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., pp. 228-259, 1986.
  • McDowell, J., Mind and World, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1994.
  • Nagel, T., “What it is like to be a Bat” in Philosophical Review, 83, pp. 435-56, 1974.
  • Peacocke, C., Sense and Content, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1983.
  • Peacocke, C., A Study of Concepts, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1992.
  • Putnam, H., “The Meaning of Meaning” in Philosophical Papers, Volume 2, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1975.
  • Tye, M., Consciousness, Color, and Content, A Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2002.
  • Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical Investigations, tr. G. E. M. Anscombe, Blackwell, Oxford, 1953.

Suggestions for Further Reading

For indirect realism see:

  • Ayer, A. J., The Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, MacMillan, London, 1947.
  • Russell, B., The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
  • Grice, H. P., “The Causal Theory of Perception” in Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
  • Jackson, F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1977.

For phenomenalism see:

  • Mill, J., An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy, Longmans Green, London, 1867.
  • Berkeley, G., A Treatise Concerning the Principles of Human Knowledge, in Berkeley: Philosophical Works, ed. M. R. Ayers (1975) Dent, London, 1710.
  • Chisholm, R., “The Problem of Empiricism” in Journal of Philosophy, 45, pp. 512-517, 1948.

For intentionalism see:

  • Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, A Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
  • Armstrong, D. M., Perception and the Physical World, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1961.

For disjunctivism see:

  • Hinton, J. M., Experiences, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1973.
  • McDowell, J., ‘Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge’ in Mind, Knowledge and Reality (1998) Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1982.

Author Information

Daniel O’Brien
Email: dan_obi@hotmail.com
The University of Birmingham
U. S. A.

Knowledge of Language

People are language users: they read, write, speak, and listen; and they do all of these things in natural languages such as English, Russian, and Arabic. Many philosophers and linguists have been interested in knowing what accounts for this facility that language users have with their language. A language may be thought of as an abstract system, characterized either as a set of grammatical rules or as an axiomatic theoretical structure (think, for example, of the way one would characterize chess as a set of rules, or the way one conceives of geometry as an axiomatic system). So the question may be posed: What relationship do speakers of a language have to the abstract system that constitutes the language they speak? The most popular line of thought is to cast this relationship in terms of knowledge, specifically, knowledge about linguistic facts: those who have mastered English have knowledge about the syntax and semantics of English. Moreover, it is because they have this knowledge that they are able to read, write, speak, and have conversations in English. Though this view is widely accepted, it is not without its objectors, and in the present article we shall examine the arguments for attributing linguistic knowledge to speakers and shall also think about the nature of this knowledge.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. What is it that Speakers of a Language Know?
  3. Why Think that Speakers of a Language have Knowledge about their Language?
    1. The Language Learning Argument
    2. A Psychoanalytic Argument: Recognition from the Inside
    3. The Behavior Rationalizing Argument
    4. The Novel Sentence Recognition Argument
    5. The Rule-Following Argument
    6. The Optimal Simulation Argument
    7. Summary
  4. What Kind of Knowledge is Tacit Knowledge?
    1. Linguistic Knowledge as Knowledge-How
    2. Isolated Knowledge
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Alex Barber puts the thesis we shall be investigating this way:

…ordinary language users possess structures of knowledge, reasonably so called, of a complex system of rules or principles of language. (2003b, 3)

And Robert Matthews characterizes what he calls the “Received View” similarly:

Knowing a language is a matter of knowing the system of rules and principles that is the grammar for that language. To have such knowledge is to have an explicit internal representation of these rules and principles, which speakers use in the course of language production and understanding. (2003, 188-9)

Though this view is widely accepted, it is not without its objectors, and in the present article we shall examine the arguments for attributing linguistic knowledge to speakers and shall also think about the nature of this knowledge.

There are three major questions that need to be addressed. First, assuming that it is correct to say that masters of a language have knowledge about their language, there is the question of what, precisely, they know. Stephen Stich (1971), in a discussion of speakers’ knowledge of syntactic principles and concepts, distinguishes three alternatives. (A) Speakers of a language might be said to know facts about the particular properties of particular sentences and expressions of their language. Those who speak English, for instance, might be said to know that “Mary had a little lamb” is ambiguous, or that “Nancy likes Ben” and “Ben is liked by Nancy” are related as active and passive voice transformations. (B) More generally, speakers might be said to know the syntactic and/or semantic theory for their language. Speakers of English might be said, on this alternative view, to know the entire Davidsonian truth theory for English or to know, on the syntactic side, that NPDet+Adj+N is a rule of the grammar of English. (Stich, 1971, 480). (C) Finally, and most generally, speakers might be said to know the principles and rules of what linguists call universal grammar. That is, they might be said to know “that all human languages have phrase structure and transformational rules, or that the grammar of every language contains the rule S NP+VP.” (Stich, 1971, 480). In more recent discussions of this topic which have centered on knowledge of a Davidsonian truth theory for the language rather than on knowledge of syntactic principles, the issue has been whether speakers know only the theorems of the truth theory or the axioms as well.

Second, why should we think that the relevant relationship is one of knowledge at all? The movements of a bicyclist who successfully rounds a corner are properly described by a complicated set of equations in physics, but there is certainly no need for the bicyclist to know these equations in order to keep her balance. In a similar vein, then, why can we not say that the linguistic behavior of a speaker of English is merely properly described by the semantic and syntactic rules of English? Why, in other words, must we say that speakers of English know the rules of English instead of merely saying that their linguistic behavior is correctly described by those rules in the way that the bicyclist’s behavior is correctly described by the laws of physics? This article will briefly look at some of the more prominent arguments for the thesis that masters of a language know the semantic and syntactic theories of their language.

Third, and perhaps most importantly, there is the question of what sort of knowledge linguistic knowledge is. All the participants in this debate agree that if masters of English have knowledge of the semantic and/or syntactic theory of English, this knowledge is importantly different from more ordinary sorts of knowledge. In addition to other important differences between knowledge of language and more ordinary sorts of knowledge, those who allegedly have knowledge of language are rarely, if ever, able to say what it is they know and the knowledge in question is largely, if not entirely, inaccessible to consciousness. The term “tacit knowledge” has been introduced to mark this distinction. Ruth, an English speaker, may know, in the ordinary sense of the term, that Chicago is the largest city in Illinois (if asked, for instance, what the largest city in Illinois is, she will answer correctly), but the knowledge she has of the semantic theory of English is best characterized as “tacit” since she is unable, among other things, to think about or tell someone else the content of what she knows. We shall discuss further the arguments for thinking that the knowledge we have of our language is tacit, the ways in which tacit knowledge differs from knowledge in the ordinary sense of the term, and the different conceptions of tacit knowledge that have been offered over the years.

2. What is it that Speakers of a Language Know?

The question of tacit linguistic knowledge has come up in connection with two separate issues in the philosophy of language. It first arose in the 1960s in connection with Noam Chomsky’s claim that every speaker of a natural language knows both the grammar of the language she speaks (English, Arabic, and so on) as well as the universal grammar which specifies linguistic universals, or grammatical properties of all natural languages. Chomsky’s claims drew the attention of philosophers not simply because of his claims of tacit linguistic knowledge, but because he claimed that knowledge of the universal grammar was innate to human beings. This claim, inasmuch as it seemed to revive certain key principles of 17th Century Rationalism, quickly attracted critical attention from the philosophical world. According to Chomsky’s view (at least as it was once expressed) human beings are born knowing the principles of universal grammar and, by deploying those principles in an environment of, say, English speakers, they come to learn the grammar of English. Knowing the grammar of English, Chomsky further claimed, is necessary for being able to read, write, speak, and understand English. Since Chomsky’s concern was primarily with the syntactic rules and principles of a language, the debate surrounding Chomsky’s nativism became a debate about whether or not speakers have syntactical (or, as it is frequently called, grammatical) knowledge of their language. In connection with this debate, philosophers have seen fit to think about three separate knowledge claims:

(a) That speakers of a language know the grammatical properties of individual expressions of their language;

(b) That speakers of a language know the particular grammatical rules of a natural language; and

(c) That speakers of a language know the principles of universal grammar. (See Stich, 1971, and Graves, et. al., 1973 for this taxonomy)

Most of our discussion here will focus on (a) and (b), though we will make some brief mention of claim (c). One of the central issues in this debate turns on the fact that the grammatical rules for any natural language are abstract, technical, and complex and, as such, are formulated in concepts that the average speaker does not possess. Because of these features of the grammatical rules, many philosophers are hesitant to ascribe knowledge of them to speakers. In the second place, the issue of tacit linguistic knowledge arose in connection with the truth-theoretic semantics inspired by the work of Donald Davidson. Davidson was more concerned with semantics than with syntax, and was interested in the project of constructing a semantic theory for a natural language. These theories (known in the literature as “T-theories” or “Truth-theories”) have an axiomatic structure, with the axioms specifying the meanings of the atomic elements of the language (roughly, the words) and the theorems — which are logically derived from the axioms — specifying the meanings of the sentences. Here the question of a speaker’s linguistic knowledge is the question of whether competent speakers of a language must be said to know the truth theory for their language, and, if they do, whether they are to be credited with knowledge of the theorems alone, or with knowledge of the axioms as well (though Davidson himself was not interested in this particular question).

One of the central issues in the debate over knowledge of the axioms of a truth theory is the idea that there are multiple ways of axiomatizing the same set of theorems. If English speakers are said to know the axioms of the truth theory for English, which axiom set do they know? In addition to this problem of multiple axiomatizations, the issues of complexity and inaccessibility to the consciousness of speakers that arise in the Chomskian debate also surface here.

3. Why Think that Speakers of a Language have Knowledge about their Language?

It is clear that speakers’ linguistic knowledge, if they have it, is an odd sort of knowledge. That is, such knowledge differs in significant ways from ordinary, everyday knowledge. Though a complete analysis of the conditions for knowledge is well beyond the scope of this article, Stich lays out some relevant features of ordinary knowledge:

Commonly when a person knows that p he has occasionally reflected that p or has been aware that p; he will, if inclined to be truthful and otherwise psychologically normal, assert that p if asked. More basic still, he is capable of understanding some statement which expresses what he knows. (1971, 485-6)

But these conditions are rarely, if ever, met in the case of language users’ knowledge of the grammatical principles of their language. Martin Davies (1989) identifies three significant differences between tacit knowledge and knowledge ordinarily so called: propositions that are tacitly known are (i) inaccessible to the knower’s consciousness, (ii) deploy concepts which the knower only tacitly possesses and (iii) are inferentially isolated from other propositions that the knower may know. (The inferential isolation of linguistic knowledge will be discussed in Section IV below.) The upshot of these considerations is that the argumentative burden is on the advocates of linguistic knowledge. After all, without such an argument, an appeal to Occam’s Razor would seem to tell us that the simplest approach is simply to say that speakers’ linguistic behavior is merely accurately described by the principles of a semantic or syntactic theory, not that they actually know the theory itself. (Think back to our example of the bicyclist: given that most bicyclists couldn’t tell us or even bring to their own consciousness the details of the physical equations that describe their cycling behavior, without an argument for attributing them knowledge of those equations, we should say only that their behavior is accurately described by those equations.) In this section we shall look at some of the more prominent arguments for the attribution of linguistic knowledge to masters of a language.

a. The Language Learning Argument

There are some accounts of the nature of language learning that seem to imply that masters of a language have knowledge about their language. According to some accounts, a child learning a language is involved in much the same sort of activity as a field linguist who is trying to figure out the language of the natives she is studying. The field linguist is involved in constructing a theory of the native language: the linguist formulates hypotheses about what certain words and phrases mean, tests these hypotheses (perhaps by making predictions about what the natives would say in a certain situation, or by talking to the natives and making predictions about their replies to her), and modifies her theory in light of the results of those tests. The idea is that infant language learners are “little linguists” involved in the same sort of process: the infant is engaged in the formulating, testing, and revision of hypotheses about the meaning and structure of the language being spoken by those around him. Of course, on this picture of language learning as theory construction, the theory construction takes place at a subconscious level and the hypotheses are formulated in the so-called Language of Thought, which is distinct from any natural language.

If this account of language learning is true (Quine, for one, seems to be a proponent of it), then it must be the case that language learners have linguistic knowledge. For one, the language learners will know the results of their theory. In much the way that the linguist, at the end of the day, knows that “toktok” is the native word for “fire”, so the language learner will know the meanings of the words of the language he has learned. Second, the language learner must have knowledge of the concepts required for the formulation of his hypotheses. If, for instance, the hypotheses formulated by the language learner include claims like “‘The large box’ is a noun phrase” and “‘The box was painted by Nancy’ is in the passive voice”, then the language learner must know what noun phrases are and what it means for a sentence to be in the passive voice. To formulate hypotheses about noun phrases, the passive voice, and other semantic and syntactic categories, the language learner must have knowledge about those categories. Or, to put the point another way, the language learner must possess the concepts he deploys in the hypotheses he formulates in the process of learning the language.

This argument is not without its objections. For one, there are philosophers who reject the model of language learners as “little linguists”. Second, even if this account of language learning is true, it tells us nothing about whether linguistic knowledge (that is, knowledge of the semantics and syntax of a natural language) is involved in our everyday use of language. Perhaps, even if knowledge is involved in learning a language, such knowledge plays the same role that training wheels play in learning how to ride a bicycle: though necessary for learning how to cycle, they are jettisoned afterward. When mature cyclists ride, they are not using training wheels, and it might similarly be the case that when mature language users use their language they are no longer utilizing the knowledge which they made use of in acquiring it. What we are interested in here is whether using a language in everyday reading, writing, and conversing requires that the language users draw on linguistic knowledge, and so, the present argument is, taken by itself, incomplete.

b. A Psychoanalytic Argument: Recognition from the Inside

Language users sometimes, though not frequently, reflect on the semantic features of their language. They may do so on their own or they may do it in the course of being interviewed by a linguist. In the course of such reflection, language users make judgments about the semantic and syntactic properties of, and relations among, sentences. So, presented with a set of English sentences, masters of English will be able to match up those in the active voice with their synonymous passive versions, or declarative sentences with the corresponding questions, and so on.

One might think that something about the explicit linguistic judgments that language users make in the course of this second order, metalinguistic reflection requires the attribution of linguistic knowledge. Perhaps the fact that language users are able to make explicit judgments about the semantic properties of sentences they have never encountered before is reason to say that they must have known semantic truths beforehand. Thomas Nagel (1969) has argued that a certain feature of the reflective process — the fact that when presented with certain propositions of semantic and syntactic theories, language users recognize them “from the inside” as correct — implicates prior linguistic knowledge.

As already mentioned, one of the large obstacles barring the way to ascriptions of linguistic knowledge is the fact that the propositions of the relevant semantic theories are highly complex and involve technical theoretical concepts. In light of these facts, Nagel wonders under what conditions it may be proper to attribute knowledge of such propositions to speakers. Nagel turns his attention to “unconscious knowledge in the ordinary psychoanalytic sense” for a clue.

The psychoanalytic ascription of unconscious knowledge, or unconscious motives for that matter, does not depend simply on the possibility of organizing the subject’s responses and actions in conformity with the alleged unconscious material. In addition, although he does not formulate his conscious knowledge or attitude of his own accord, and may deny it upon being asked, it is usually possible to bring him by analytic techniques to see that the statement in question expresses something that he knows or feels. That is, he is able eventually to acknowledge the statement as an expression of his own belief, if it is presented to him clearly enough and in the right circumstances. Thus what was unconscious can be brought, at least partly, to consciousness. It is essential that his acknowledgment not be based merely on the observation of his own responses and behavior, and that he come to recognize the rightness of the attribution from the inside. (1969, 175-6)

Nagel then offers the following proposal for attribution of unconscious or tacit knowledge:

…where recognition of this sort is possible in principle, there is good reason to speak of knowledge and belief, even in cases where the relevant principles or statements have not yet been consciously acknowledged, or even in cases where they will never be explicitly formulated. (1969, 176)

and claims that this sort of recognition exists in the linguistic realm:

…we may observe that accurate formulations of grammatical rules often evoke the same sense of recognition from speakers who have been conforming to them for years, that is evoked by the explicit formulation of repressed material which has been influencing one’s behavior for years. (1969, 176)

Accordingly, he concludes, we have reason to attribute linguistic knowledge to language users. Nagel has, it seems, found a phenomenon — recognition “from the inside” of the correctness of a rule or principle — which is adequately explained only by the ascription of prior knowledge. We cannot make adequate sense of this “Of course! That’s it! I knew it all along!” phenomenon unless (or so it is argued) we say that language users had knowledge prior to being questioned.

There are two objections to this argument. First, even if this is sound, we would need to hear more about how this applies to unreflective language use. In general, one may try to explain some feature of explicit linguistic judgments in terms of linguistic knowledge, but in order for us to conclude that first order language use involves the active deployment of linguistic knowledge, we need an argument for the claim that first order language use consists in making explicit linguistic judgments. To build on the earlier analogy of cycling, we may say that a cyclist has all sorts of knowledge of the mechanical workings of his bicycle — and we may show that he does by interviewing him before the race in his garage — but it does not follow that he is deploying or using that knowledge in the course of cycling.

Second, as Stich (1971) has claimed, it is doubtful that we can actually bring speakers to this sort of recognition. While it is certainly possible to do this with some linguistic rules, the fact that the rules which, according to linguists and philosophers, constitute any natural language are exceedingly abstract, complex, and technical would argue against the possibility of bringing speakers of a language to this “from-the-inside” recognition of the linguistic rules of that language.

c. The Behavior Rationalizing Argument

The two arguments we have just examined fail to give us conclusive reasons for thinking that ordinary every day language use requires the attribution of linguistic knowledge to speakers. While they may take us some of the way toward that conclusion, they are, at best, incomplete. The Behavior Rationalizing Argument, by contrast, focuses precisely on everyday language use to establish its conclusion and is, for that reason, a stronger argument.

One common justification for ascribing knowledge to people is that such knowledge ascriptions are necessary to explain their behavior. So, to borrow an example from Ernest LePore, a proponent of this argument, if we see Cinderella running and seek to explain that behavior of hers, we will naturally ascribe to her a desire (say, to be home by midnight) and some beliefs (say, that it is almost midnight and that she won’t get home by midnight unless she runs). The only way to rationalize (i.e make sense of) Cinderella’s behavior is to ascribe some set of beliefs and desires to her. So far, this is merely standard belief-desire psychology and has nothing in particular to do with linguistic knowledge. LePore, however, has adapted this argument to make the case for linguistic knowledge, and it is that adaptation that constitutes the “Behavior Rationalizing Argument” for linguistic knowledge.

LePore asks us to imagine that Cinderella begins running because Arabella has yelled to her, “It’s almost midnight!” In this case, in order to make sense of Cinderella’s behavior, it seems we have to ascribe to Cinderella at least three additional beliefs:

(i) that Arabella uttered the sentence “It’s almost midnight”; and

(ii) that “It’s almost midnight” means that it’s almost midnight; and

(iii) that Arabella is telling the truth

Claiming that Cinderella has these three beliefs seems necessary to adequately explain why Cinderella believes, upon hearing Arabella, that it’s almost midnight. (And, given her belief that she can get home by midnight only if she runs and her desire to be home by midnight, we can understand why she is running.) Notice, however, that if this is the story to tell, we have, with (ii), ascribed to Cinderella a belief about the semantic properties of a particular English sentence. If Cinderella runs because Arabella yelled to her “It’s almost midnight,” it seems that rationalizing Cinderella’s behavior requires attributing to Cinderella a belief about the linguistic properties of a sentence of her language. Rationalizing Cinderella’s behavior, therefore, requires that we attribute linguistic knowledge to Cinderella.

The point can be further appreciated if we imagine that Cinderella does not understand English. Upon Arabella’s yelling “It’s almost midnight”, Cinderella may still form beliefs (i) and (iii), (belief (i), note, is just about the words that Arabella has uttered; even if she doesn’t understand English, Cinderella may still believe that Arabella has uttered certain words) but she will not begin running. The reason she will not is because she has not understood what Arabella has said. That is, she lacks belief (ii). This seems to be a strong case for conceiving of a speaker’s understanding of the language in terms of linguistic knowledge of the language itself. LePore puts the point this way:

What about understanding language justifies, for example, the belief that it is midnight, when this understanding combines with other attitudes, for example, the belief that Arabella uttered “It’s [almost] midnight”? It is hard to see how else we could justify such a belief without ascribing additional beliefs, knowledge, or other propositional attitudes the speaker might have but the non-speaker lack. (1986, 5)

Such, then, is the Behavior Rationalizing Argument for the conclusion that speakers of a language have beliefs about the meanings of particular sentences of their language. The behavior of language users (in particular, their reactions to the utterances of others) shows that they have beliefs about what sentences of their language mean. Upon noticing a sign in a shop window that reads “Free philosophy books inside!” Cinderella enters the shop. Rationalizing her behavior requires that we ascribe to Cinderella the belief that there are free philosophy books inside the shop. And the best explanation for how she came by that belief is that she knows what the English sentence “Free philosophy books inside!” means. And so on for her reactions to other sentences of English. It is only if we ascribe linguistic knowledge to English speakers that we can make sense of their behavior. What is important about this argument is that it appeals to ordinary, everyday, features of language use, and that is one of its strengths.

One of the limitations of this argument, however, is that it succeeds in attributing to speakers knowledge of the semantic properties of only particular sentences of their language. In terms of Davidsonian theories of meaning, in other words, it is an argument that Cinderella knows the theorems of those theories. For an argument that Cinderella knows more than this, we need to turn to the Novel Sentence Recognition argument.

d. The Novel Sentence Recognition Argument

This is perhaps one of the best known, and most relied upon, arguments for linguistic knowledge, and we can approach it by picking up where the Behavior Rationalizing Argument left off. That argument, if sound, has established that speakers’ understanding of the sentences of their language consists in their having beliefs about the meanings of those sentences. Now, philosophers and linguists have long been impressed by the fact that, after being exposed to only a small number of strings of language, masters of a language are able to understand a potential infinity of previously unencountered strings of language. After exposure to only a small number of English sentences, speakers are able to recognize, of just about any English sentence — including sentences they have never seen or heard before — what that sentence means. This is a remarkable feat, and cries out for explanation. As Crispin Wright characterizes it, the central project of theoretical linguistics is to “explain our recognition of the syntax and sense of novel sentences” (1989, 258), and, according to the Novel Sentence Recognition Argument, the best such explanation will appeal to cognitive states of language users.

The best explanation of speakers’ ability to have beliefs about the meanings of a potential infinity of sentences involves the claim that speakers are deriving their belief about the meaning of a sentence from other beliefs about (simplifying a bit) the meanings of the component words. The reason why Nancy has a belief about the meaning of a sentence she has never encountered before is that she already has beliefs about the meanings of all the words (and semantic significance of the syntax) in that sentence. Since Nancy’s beliefs about the meanings of the sentences are viewed as beliefs about the theorems of a Davidsonian theory of meaning, we can view the conclusion of this argument as attributing to Nancy beliefs about the axioms of the theory.

It may help to think about the language itself, setting aside the question of speakers’ knowledge of the language. What is it that allows for the construction of novel sentences of English, sentences that have never before been constructed? Surely it is the fact that English is compositional: sentences are constructed out of words, to put it simply. A finite collection of words can be arranged in an infinite number of ways, generating the potential infinity of English sentences. This compositionality applies, then, to the structure of speakers’ knowledge of their language: their ability to understand (which, according to the Behavior Rationalizing Argument, consists in having a semantic belief) a potential infinity of sentences is rooted in their knowledge of the axioms of the theory of meaning.

e. The Rule-Following Argument

Inspired by Wittgenstein’s discussion in The Philosophical Investigations, there is a tradition according to which speaking a language is conceived of as a matter of following a set of rules: the language itself is conceived of as a set of rules (as chess is) and those who speak the language are following those rules in the course of their language use, much like chess players are following the rules of chess as they play. John Searle is a proponent of this view of language use:

Speaking a language is engaging in a (highly complex) rule-governed form of behavior. To learn and master a language is (inter alia) to learn and to have mastered these rules. This is a familiar view in philosophy and linguistics. (Searle, 1969, 12)

Somewhat later, and more simply, Searle says this: “speaking a language is performing acts according to rules.” (1969, 36) If we adopt this view, we can construct an argument for attributing linguistic knowledge to speakers of a language.

The first point to make is that there is an important difference between, on the one hand, following a rule or being guided by a rule, and, on the other hand, acting in accordance with a rule or having one’s behavior correctly described by a rule. Quine illustrates the distinction this way:

Imagine two systems of English grammar: one an old-fashioned system that draws heavily on the Latin grammarians, and the other a streamlined formulation due to Jespersen. Imagine that the two systems are extensionally equivalent, in this sense: they determine, recursively, the same infinite set of well-formed English sentences. In Denmark the boys in one school learn English by the one system, and those in another school learn it by the other. In the end all the boys sound alike. Both systems of rules fit the behavior of all the boys, but each system guides the behavior of only half the boys. (Quine, 1972, 442)

Only half of the boys are following the Jespersen rules (because only half the boys learned the Jespersen rules), but all the boys are acting in accordance with the Jespersen rules. That is, the behavior of all of the boys is correctly described by the Jespersen rules. Or, put differently, none of the behavior of any of the boys ever violates the Jespersen rules.

According to advocates of the Rule-Following Argument, fluent speakers of English are to be thought of as following the rules of English and not as merely acting in accordance with them. What is the difference between one who is following a rule and one who is merely acting in accordance with it? The Rule-Following Argument claims that drawing this distinction requires attributing knowledge of the rules to fluent speakers.

The argument goes like this. First, an agent is following a rule only if that rule is somehow involved in the explanation of her behavior. If we say that Nancy, while playing chess, is following the rule “Bishops may move diagonally only”, then we commit ourselves to the view that the explanation of why Nancy acted as she did will appeal to that rule. By contrast, that rule does not appear in the explanation of the behavior of someone who is merely acting in accordance with that rule. Second, the way in which the rule shows up as part of the explanation of Nancy’s rule-following behavior is that the rule appears as one of the causes of her behavior. Accordingly, the rule is not involved in the causal explanation of the behavior of someone who is merely acting in accordance with that rule. The most we can say of a rule with which an agent is merely acting in accordance is that the rule truly describes her behavior. The rule is among the causes of the behavior of an agent who is following that rule. Third, and finally, a rule features as a cause of an agent’s behavior because the agent knows, or somehow has present to mind, that rule. From these three claims, we get the conclusion that fluent speakers of a language (whose linguistic behavior is conceived of as rule-following behavior) have linguistic knowledge: they know the rules they are following. Rosenberg gives a nice description of this position:

Learning to behave according to certain rules is, presumably, learning to pursue or eschew certain activities. But it is not simply that. A pigeon who has been trained (conditioned) to peck at a key under certain circumstances has not learned to behave according to any rules. What more is required is that the activities in question be pursued or eschewed because they are enjoined or proscribed by the rules. If an agent is following a rule in the course of his activities, then the rule in question must, in some sense, be “present to the mind.” (1974, 31)

This Rule-Following Argument, with its talk of the difference between following a rule and acting in accordance with a rule, differs in its starting point from the Behavior Rationalizing Argument. Its focus is on making sense of agents’ responses to their interlocutors’ utterances, but it ends up in much the same place: fluent language users have linguistic knowledge and make use of that knowledge in the course of their language use.

f. The Optimal Simulation Argument

Jerry Fodor defends “intellectualist” accounts of psychology, and, in the course of so doing, provides another argument for the attribution of tacit knowledge to language users. Fodor is concerned with psychology generally, and not simply with the explanation of linguistic behavior, and so fully appreciating the argument requires that we briefly review his intellectualist position.

According to Fodor, the explanation for how people snap their fingers or tie their shoes is that there are instructions for how to do these things — descriptions, in terms of the elementary operations of our nervous, perceptual, and muscular systems — and that these instructions are encapsulated as information in our minds. Since, in snapping our fingers or tying our shoes, we are applying these instructions, we must know them. Fodor frequently uses the images of “little men in our heads”, but the cash value of this metaphor is simply that the information is somehow represented in our minds. Whenever we tie our shoes, little agents in our head (and in other parts of our nervous system) execute the instructions encapsulated in the “instruction manual” for shoe tying. To say that we know how to tie our shoes is simply to say that we know the instructions for doing so. What makes his position an intellectualist one is precisely this appeal to represented information as part of the explanation of our behavior. As Fodor himself puts it, “The intellectualist account of X-ing says that, whenever you X, the little man in your head has access to and employs a manual on X-ing; and surely whatever is his is yours.” (1968, 636)

Fodor is sensitive to the fact that those of us who possess this knowledge are unable to answer the question, “How does one X”? That is, Ruth may be unable to explain (in terms of nerve firings and muscle contractions and so on) how it is she snaps her fingers, but, all the same, she knows the instructions for finger snapping which are formulated in terms of nerve firings and muscle contractions. Thus, Fodor acknowledges, this knowledge must be tacit, and he seeks to provide an argument for saying, despite her inability to say how she X-es, that Ruth knows the instructions for X-ing. His argument appeals to optimal simulations of an organism’s behavior — that is, to a machine or computer program, or some other artificial device that would simulate the organism’s behavior.

Fodor’s position on tacit knowledge attributions is aptly summed up thus:

…if X is something an organism knows how to do but is unable to explain how to do, and if S is some sequence of operations, the specification of which would constitute an answer to the question “How do you X?,” and if an optimal simulation of the behavior of the organism X-s by running through the sequence of operations specified by S, then the organism tacitly knows the answer to the question “How do you X?,” and S is a formulation of the organism’s tacit knowledge. (1968, 638)

If we build a robot that optimally simulates Ruth’s finger snapping behavior, and the robot runs through a series of instructions S1, S2, S3, and so on, then, according to Fodor, Ruth tacitly knows S1, S2, S3, and so on A particularly odd feature of this proposal is that it draws a conclusion about Ruth upon noticing something about a robot. The fact that we can build a robot to simulate Ruth’s (or any human being’s) finger snapping shouldn’t give us any evidence at all about Ruth, should it? As Fodor puts it, “how could any fact about the computational operations of some machine (even a machine that optimally simulates the behavior of an organism) provide grounds for asserting that an epistemic relation [that is, tacit knowledge] holds between an organism and a proposition?” (638)

It is at this stage that Fodor deploys the following, seemingly reasonable, inductive principle: From like effects, infer like causes. Since the robot and Ruth are exhibiting similar effects, and we know the cause of the robot’s behavior — it is running through the instructions — we can infer (inductively, of course) that Ruth’s behavior has a similar cause.

If machines and organisms can produce behaviors of the same type and if descriptions of machine computations in terms of the rules, instructions, and so on, that they employ are true descriptions of the etiology of their output, then the principle that licenses inferences from like effects to like causes must license us to infer that the tacit knowledge of organisms is represented by the programs of the machines that simulate their behavior. (640)

So far we have spoken in general terms about the behavior of organisms — shoe tying, finger snapping, and so on, — but, of course, we can apply Fodor’s argument to linguistic behavior. Since speaking English or reading German or having a conversation in Arabic are intelligent behaviors on a par with shoe tying and finger snapping, if we can (a) arrive at a specification of a set of instructions for how one does these things — a set of instructions which will, in all likelihood, make reference to the semantic and syntactic theories of these languages — and if we can (b) produce an optimal simulation of such language use which simulates human language use by running through those instructions, then we can, by Fodor’s reasoning, conclude that human speakers of those languages have tacit knowledge of the semantic and syntactic theories of the languages they speak.

g. Summary

We have seen a number of arguments that attempt to establish that speakers of a language have knowledge of the semantic and syntactic properties of the words and sentences of their language. It is worth reiterating that the argumentative ball is in the court of the proponent of linguistic knowledge: the many ways in which linguistic knowledge, if it exists, differs from ordinary knowledge puts the burden of argument on the philosopher who advocates the position that every ordinary speaker of a language has syntactic and semantic knowledge.

The arguments assembled here are, in one way or another, all arguments to the best explanation. There are some phenomena (language learning, novel sentence recognition, behavior in response to an utterance, and so on) which, according to the arguments, can best (or, perhaps, only) be explained by the attribution of knowledge to the speakers. This is a perfectly legitimate form of argument, of course, and may ultimately carry the day. But, as with all such arguments, they are vulnerable to the objector who thinks either that the phenomena in question do not need explanation or can be explained in simpler terms — that is, terms that don’t require knowledge attribution.

If, however, we accept the conclusion of these arguments, we need next to investigate the nature of tacit knowledge. In what respects is tacit knowledge like other, more familiar sorts of knowledge? In what ways is it different? Might it be so different as to not qualify as knowledge at all? These are some of the questions we shall be discussing in the final section.

4. What Kind of Knowledge is Tacit Knowledge?

If we accept the conclusion of the above arguments and, consequently, attribute tacit knowledge of a language to speakers of that language, the question that next presents itself is this: what sort of knowledge is tacit knowledge? How is tacit knowledge of a language like other sorts of knowledge that we ordinarily ascribe to people?

a. Linguistic Knowledge as Knowledge-How

A common move by those who are somewhat skeptical of the attribution of tacit linguistic knowledge is to draw a distinction between propositional knowledge and practical knowledge, or, more colloquially, between “knowledge that” and “knowledge how”. (Ryle (1949) is credited with the original distinction, but also see Stanley and Williamson (2001) for a more recent treatment.) The distinction is meant to emphasize that not all knowledge should be regarded as a relationship between a knower and a proposition. So, for instance, when we say

(1) Sophie knows that Paris is the capital of France

we usually understand that attribution in terms of Sophie’s relationship to the proposition expressed by the sentence “Paris is the capital of France.” To possess that knowledge, accordingly, Sophie must bear some sort of cognitive relationship to that proposition. She must, in some sense, “have that proposition before her mind”. By contrast, were we to say

(2) Sophie knows how to swim

we would not thereby be attributing to Sophie any relationship to any propositions. There may be a good many propositions that accurately describe what Sophie is doing while she is swimming (“Sophie is kicking her feet 75 times a minute”, “Sophie is traveling 5 miles an hour”, and so on) but, the position holds, she need not bear any cognitive relationship to those propositions in order for us to truly assert (2). To say that Sophie knows how to do something is to attribute to Sophie a practical ability, but in doing so (if we accept the knowledge-that/knowledge-how distinction) we do not attribute to her cognitive relationships to a particular set of propositions.

Some have argued that the sort of knowledge that speakers have of their language should be conceived of as knowledge-how. Wittgenstein gives voice to the sentiment in the Investigations thus:

To understand a sentence means to understand a language. To understand a language means to be master of a technique. (1958, para. 199)

But is has been more clearly asserted more recently by Anthony Kenny:

To know a language is to have an ability: the ability to speak, understand, and perhaps read the language. (1989, 20)

and by Michael Devitt who claims that we should view linguistic competence

not as semantic propositional knowledge, but as an ability or skill: It is knowledge-how not knowledge-that. (1996, 25)

To accept this line of thought is to conceive of the propositions that constitute the grammar or theory of meaning for a particular language as accurately describing the linguistic behavior of speakers; those propositions are not to be conceived of as the content of speakers’ propositional attitudes.

There are a number of reasons for accepting the view that linguistic knowledge is knowledge-how, but perhaps the most popular line of thought is this: Since, or so it has been claimed, propositional knowledge, or knowledge-that, requires that one understand a language (the language in which the propositions are represented), linguistic understanding cannot, on pains of regress or circularity, be analyzed in terms of propositional knowledge. We cannot, it is argued, analyze Cinderella’s understanding of English in terms of her knowledge of a set of English sentences of the sort found in, say, Davidsonian meaning theories, for example,

“Snow is white” is true if and only if snow is white

because knowing the propositions expressed by those sentences requires understanding English.

There are responses to this argument and there are, as mentioned, other reasons to endorse the view that linguistic knowledge should be viewed as knowledge-how. Moreover, and perhaps more importantly, there are arguments against the knowledge-how/knowledge-that distinction. Stanley and Williamson have argued that “all knowing-how is knowing-that” (2001, 444). If their argument stands up to scrutiny, it makes the project of trying to analyze linguistic knowledge as a species of practical knowledge much more difficult. The topic of practical knowledge and its relationship to propositional knowledge is a fascinating one, and the brevity of this discussion here should not be taken as a dismissal of the importance or complexity of the existing debate.

b. Isolated Knowledge

If we accept that speakers of a language have propositional knowledge of the grammar, or meaning theory, for their language, we need to think about the ways in which that knowledge is like other sorts of propositional knowledge. One condition that seems satisfied by ordinary beliefs (and states of knowledge) is the following:

Beliefs (and states of knowledge) are the sorts of states that interact with the believer’s desires and which must potentially be at the service of many of the believer’s different projects.

Gareth Evans has endorsed this condition on beliefs:

It is the essence of a belief state that it be at the service of many distinct projects, and that its influence on any project be mediated by other beliefs. (1981, 132)

So consider Susie who believes that a pot of soup is laced with cyanide. According to this condition on beliefs, Susie counts as having this belief (and, if she meets other conditions, counts as knowing that the soup is laced with cyanide) only if it is possible for this cognitive state to serve a number of different projects. Susie’s belief might lead to her refusing to eat the soup herself, to her keeping her friends from eating the soup, to serving the soup to her enemies, and, if Susie further believes that ingesting a bit of cyanide each day for a month renders one immune to its effects and desires to develop a cyanide immunity, her belief that the soup is laced with cyanide might lead to her taking a spoonful of it each day for a month. Susie thus stands in contrast to a laboratory rat to whom, given its conditioning, we might be tempted to attribute the belief that the soup is laced with cyanide. What makes it the case that the rat does not have a genuine belief is that this belief leads to only one kind of behavior — avoiding eating the soup. This putative belief of the rat’s does not help to explain anything else the rat does, and because of this, it does not count as a genuine belief.

The plausibility of this condition on our ordinary concept of belief emerges when we realize that these multiple projects are the result of multiple desires. Susie’s different desires — for her own health, for the health of her friends, for the demise of her enemies, for immunity to cyanide — are what interact with the belief that the soup is laced with cyanide to produce different behaviors. A belief is the kind of thing that can interact with multiple desires to produce behavior, and, consequently, so with knowledge. Beliefs (and thus states of knowledge) cannot be isolated to the degree that they are incapable of interacting with different desires to produce different behavior.

All of this is relevant to our discussion of linguistic knowledge because, according to many authors, the knowledge that speakers have of the grammar or meaning theory of their language is, or seems to be, isolated in the way that ordinary beliefs are not. A speaker’s linguistic beliefs(whose content are the grammatical principles of their language or the contents of the meaning theory for their language) seem to be inferentially isolated from the rest of her beliefs and from her desires. Such beliefs operate (especially if we are attracted to either the Behavior Rationalizing Argument or the Novel Sentence Recognition Argument above) simply to account for a speaker’s understanding of a string of the language. If we are convinced by the Novel Sentence Recognition Argument to ascribe to a speaker a belief about some syntactic structure, we do so only in order to explain the fact that the speaker is able to understand a sentence she has never encountered before. That belief interacts with no other desires of the speaker and is at the service of one project alone: the comprehension of encountered sentences. Accordingly, if we accept Evans’ claim, we should conclude that while an English speaker may have some cognitive relationship to the grammar or meaning theory for English, that relationship is not a full-fledged belief. It is, perhaps, not even a belief at all. Investigation of the particular cognitive status of these subdoxastic states is an important topic not just in relation to tacit linguistic knowledge, but in cognitive science generally.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Barber, Alex. ed. Epistemology of Language. Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York, 2003a.
  • Barber, Alex. “Introduction” Epistemology of Language. Ed. Alex Barber. Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York, 2003b. 1-43.
  • Davies, Martin. “Tacit Knowledge and Subdoxastic States.” Reflections on Chomsky. Ed. Alexander George. Basil Blackwell, Oxford and Cambridge,1989. 131-52.
  • Devitt, Michael. Coming to Our Senses. Cambridge University Press, Cambridge and New York, 1996.
  • Evans, Gareth. “Semantic Theory and Tacit Knowledge.” Wittgenstein: To Follow a Rule. Eds. Holtzman, S.H. and C.M. Leitch. Routledge and Kegan Paul, London,1981.
  • Fodor, Jerry. “The Appeal to Tacit Knowledge in Psychological Explanation.” Journal of Philosophy 65 (1968): 627-40.
  • George, Alexander. Reflections on Chomsky. Basil Blackwell, Oxford and Cambridge, MA, 1989.
  • Graves, Christina, et. al. “Tacit Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 70, (1973): 318-30.
  • LePore, Ernest. “Truth in Meaning.” Truth and Interpretation. Ed. Ernest Lepore, Basil Blackwell, Cambridge, MA, 1986. 3-26.
  • Matthews, Robert. “Does Linguistic Competence Require Knowledge of Language?” Epistemology of Language. Ed. Alex Barber. Oxford University Press, Oxford and New York, 2003. 187-213.
  • Nagel, Thomas. “Linguistics and Epistemology.” Language and Philosophy. Ed. Sidney Hook. New York University Press, New York, 1969. 171-82.
  • Quine, W.V. “Methodological Reflections on Current Linguistic Theory.” Semantics of Natural Language. Eds. Donald Davidson and Gilbert Harman. D. Reidel, Dordrecht, 1972. 442-454.
  • Rosenberg, Jay. (1974). Linguistic Representation. D. Reidel, Dordrecht.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. The Concept of Mind. Hutchinson, London,1949.
  • Searle, John. Speech Acts. Cambridge University Press, New York, 1969.
  • Stanley, Jason and Timothy Williamson. “Knowing How.” Journal of Philosophy, 98 (2001): 411-444.
  • Stich, Stephen. “What Every Speaker Knows.” Philosophical Review, 80 (1971): 476-96.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig. Philosophical Investigations. G.E.M. Anscombe, trans. Macmillan, New York, 1958.
  • Wright, Crispin. “Wittgenstein’s Rule-following Considerations and the Central Project of Theoretical Linguistics.” Reflections on Chomsky. Ed. Alexander George. Basil Blackwell, Oxford and Cambridge, MA, 1989. 233-64.

Author Information

Andrew P. Mills
Email: AMills@otterbein.edu
Otterbein College
U. S. A.

Mozi (Mo-tzu, c. 400s—300s B.C.E.)

moziMo Di (Mo Ti), better known as Mozi (Mo-tzu) or “Master Mo,” was a Chinese thinker active from the late 5th to the early 4th centuries B.C.E. He is best remembered for being the first major intellectual rival to Confucius and his followers. Mozi’s teaching is summed up in ten theses extensively argued for in the text that bears his name, although he himself is unlikely to have been its author. The most famous of these theses is the injunction that one ought to be concerned for the welfare of people in a spirit of “impartial concern” (jian’ai) that does not make distinctions between self and other, associates and strangers, a doctrine often described more simplistically as “universal love.” Mozi founded a quasi-religious and paramilitary community that, apart from propagating the ten theses, lent aid to small states under threat from military aggressors with their expertise in counter-siege technology. Along with the Confucians, the Mohists were one of the two most prominent schools of thought during the Warring States period (403-221 B.C.E.), although contemporary sources such as the Hanfeizi and the Zhuangzi indicate that the Mohists had divided into rival sects by this time. While Mohist communities probably did not survive into the Qin dynasty (221-206 B.C.E.), Mohist ideas exerted a decisive influence upon the thinkers of early China. Between the late 4th and late 3rd centuries B.C.E., later Mohists wrote the earliest extant Chinese treatise on logic, as well as works on geometry, optics and mechanics. Mohist logic appears to have influenced the argumentative techniques of early Chinese thinkers, while Mohist visions of meritocracy and the public good helped to shape the political philosophies and policy decisions of both the Qin and Han (202 B.C.E.-220 C.E.) imperial regimes. In these ways, Mohist ideas survived well into the early imperial era, albeit by being absorbed into other Chinese philosophical traditions.

Table of Contents

  1. Historical Background
  2. The Core Chapters of the Mozi
  3. The Ten Core Theses of Mohism
  4. The Aims and Character of Mohist Doctrine
  5. Moral Epistemology
  6. The Foundations of Mohist Morality
  7. Impartial Concern
  8. Moral Psychology and Human Nature
  9. Government
  10. Frugality
  11. Just War
  12. Heaven and Spirits
  13. References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

The details of Mozi’s life are uncertain.  Early sources identify him variously as a contemporary of Confucius or as living after Confucius’ time.  Modern scholars generally believe that Mozi was active from the late 5th to the early 4th centuries B.C.E., before the time of the Confucian philosopher Mencius, which places him in the early Warring States period (403-221 B.C.E.) of ancient Chinese history.  Little can be known of his personal life.  Some early sources say that he, like Confucius, was a native of the state of Lu (in modern Shandong) and at one point served as a minister in the state of Song (in modern Henan). According to tradition, he studied with Confucian teachers but later rebelled against their ideas.  As was the case with Confucius, Mozi probably traveled among the various contending states to present his ideas before their rulers in the hope of obtaining political employment, with an equal lack of success.

Mozi founded a highly organized quasi-religious and military community, with considerable geographical reach.  Overseen by a “Grand Master” (juzi), members of the community — “Mohists” (mozhe) — were characterized by their commitment to ten theses ascribed to “Our Teacher Master Mo” (zimozi), versions of which are articulated in the “Core Chapters” of the eponymous text.  Quite apart from propagating the teachings of Mozi, the Mohist community also functioned as an international rescue organization that dispatched members versed in the arts of defensive military techniques to the aid of small states under threat from military aggressors. This outreach presumably stemmed from the Mohists’ opposition to all forms of military aggression.

Some scholars speculate that Mozi and the Mohists probably came from a lower social class than, for instance, the Confucians, but the evidence is inconclusive and at best suggestive. Nevertheless, if the conjecture is true, it could well explain the often repetitive and artless style in which much of the Mozi is composed and the anti-aristocratic stance of much Mohist doctrine, as well as why the Mohists paid such attention to the basic economic livelihood of the common people.

2. The Core Chapters of the Mozi

The text known as the Mozi traditionally is divided into seventy-one “chapters,” some of which are marked “missing” in the received text. Most scholars believe that the Mozi was probably not written by Master Mo himself, but by successive groups of disciples and their followers. No part of the text actually claims to be written by Mozi, although many parts purport to record his doctrines and conversations.

While there remain intense and complicated scholarly disputes over the exact dating and provenance of different parts of the Mohist corpus, it is probable that chapters 8-37 (the so-called “core chapters”) derive either from the teachings of Mozi himself or from the formative period of the Mohist community and contain doctrines that were nominally adhered to by its members throughout much of the community’s existence. The core chapters are replete with the formula “the doctrine of Our Teacher Master Mo says” (zimozi yan yue), prefixed to sayings presented as records of Master Mo’s teaching.  (However, since the text most likely was not written by Mozi himself, this entry will refer to the doctrine presented in the core chapters in terms of “the Mohists” and “Mohist doctrine” rather than “Mozi” and “Mozi’s doctrine.”)

The core chapters consist of ten triads of essays, with seven chapters marked “missing.” Each triad of chapters correlates with one of the ten Mohist theses.  Traditionally, these triads correspond to the “upper” (shang), “middle” (zhong) and “lower” (xia) versions of the thesis in question; in Western scholarship, they are usually referred to as versions “A,” “B,” and “C” of the corresponding thesis.  Intriguingly, the chapters that make up each triad often are very close to each other in wording without being exactly identical, thus raising questions about the precise relationship between them and with how the text assumed its present shape. One influential theory in recent times is Angus C. Graham’s proposal that the triads correspond to oral traditions of Mohist doctrine transmitted by the three Mohist sects mentioned in the Hanfeizi, a third century B.C.E. philosophical text associated with a student of the Confucian thinker Xunzi.

Much of the core chapters is written in a style that is not calculated to please.  As Burton Watson puts it, the style is “marked by a singular monotony of sentence pattern, and a lack of wit or grace that is atypical of Chinese literature in general.”  But Watson also concedes that the Mohists’ arguments “are almost always presented in an orderly and lucid, if not logically convincing fashion.” Whether or not the arguments of the core chapters are logically convincing can only be determined on a case-by-case basis, but it is at least possible that the artless style is the consequence of a deliberate choice to prioritize clarity of argumentation.

3. The Ten Core Theses of Mohism

The contents of the ten triads and thus the outlines of the ten core theses are briefly described below:

Chapters 8-10, “Elevating the Worthy” (shangxian), argue that the policy of elevating worthy and capable people to office in government whatever their social origin is a fundamental principle of good governance.  The proper implementation of such a policy requires that the rulers attract the talented to service by the conferring of honor, the reward of wealth and the delegation of responsibility (and thus power). On the other hand, the rulers’ practice of appointing kinsmen and favorites to office without regard to their abilities is condemned.

Chapters 11-13, “Exalting Unity” (shangtong), contain a state-of-nature argument on the basis of which it is concluded that a unified conception of what is morally right (yi) consistently enforced by a hierarchy of rulers and leaders is a necessary condition for social and political order. The thesis applies to the world community as a whole, conceived as a single moral-political hierarchy with the common people at the bottom, the feudal princes in the middle, and the emperor at the summit, above whom is Heaven itself.

Chapters 14-16, “Impartial Concern” (jian’ai), argue that the cause of the world’s troubles lies in people’s tendency to act out of a greater regard for their own welfare than that of others, and that of associates over that of strangers, with the consequence that they often have no qualms about benefiting themselves or their own associates at the expense of others. The conclusion is that people ought to be concerned for the welfare of others without making distinctions between self, associates and strangers.

Chapters 17-19, “Against Military Aggression” (feigong), condemn military aggression as both unprofitable (even for the aggressors) and immoral. Version C introduces a distinction between justified and unjustified warfare, claiming that the former was waged by the righteous ancient sage rulers to overthrow evil tyrants.

Chapters 20-21 (22 is listed as “missing”), “Frugality in Expenditures” (jieyong), argue that good governance requires thrift in the ruler’s expenditures. Useless luxuries are condemned. The chapters also argue for the clear priority of functionality over form in the making of various human artifacts (clothing, buildings, armor and weapons, boats and other vehicles).

Chapter 25 (23-24 are listed as “missing”), “Frugality in Funerals” (jiezang), has the same theme as “Frugality in Expenditures,” but applies it to the specific case of funeral rituals. The aristocratic practices of elaborate funerals and prolonged mourning are condemned as “not morally right” (buyi) because they are not only useless to solving the world’s problems, but add to the people’s burdens.  Here, the Mohists target practices beloved by their Confucian contemporaries, for whom the maintenance of harmonious moral order in society is best accomplished through strict fidelity to ritual codes.

Chapters 26-28, “Heaven’s Will” (Tianzhi), argue that the will of Heaven (Tian) — portrayed as if it is a personal deity and providential agent who rewards the good and punishes the wicked — is the criterion of what is morally right.  Here again, the Mohists contrast themselves with the Confucians, who regard Heaven as a moral but mysterious force that does not intervene directly in human affairs.

Chapter 31 (29-30 are listed as “missing”), “Elucidating the Spirits” (minggui), claims that a loss of belief in the existence, power and providential character of spirits — supernatural agents of Tian tasked with enforcing its sanctions — has led to widespread immorality and social and political chaos. The chapter consists of an exchange with certain skeptics, whom Mozi answers with arguments purporting to prove that providential spirits exist, but also that widespread belief in their existence brings great social and political benefit.

Chapter 32 (33-34 are listed as “missing”), “Against Music” (feiyue), condemns the musical displays of the aristocracy as immoralon the same basis according to which elaborate funerals and prolonged mourning are condemned in “Frugality in Funerals.”  Just as in that chapter, here again the Mohists attack practices that are particularly dear to their Confucian rivals, who believe that music, if properly performed according to ancient canons, can play a vital role in the regulation of moral order and the cultivation of virtue.

Chapters 35-37, “Against Fatalism” (feiming), argue against the doctrine of fatalism (the thesis that human wisdom and effort have no effect on the outcomes of human endeavor) as pernicious and harmful in that widespread belief in it will lead to indolence and chaos. The chapters also contain crucial discussions on the general conditions or criteria (traditionally called the “Three Tests of Doctrine”) that must be met by any doctrine if it is to be considered sound. (See Section 5: “Moral Epistemology” below.)

4. The Aims and Character of Mohist Doctrine

As in the case of many other philosophical conceptions in early China, Mohist doctrine is deeply rooted in the thinkers’ response to the social and political problems that are perceived to beset the world (tianxia, “all beneath Heaven”).  In particular, the Mohists are concerned to offer a practical solution to the chaos (luan) of the world so as to restore it to good order (zhi). A way to characterize the Mohists’ concern is to say that they (like many early Chinese philosophers) seek and to put the Way (dao, the right way to live and to conduct the community’s affairs) into practice rather than merely to discover and state the Truth about the universe. But there are also several more distinctively Mohist twists to this underlying concern.

First, the Mohists tend to equate the Way with a conception of what is morally right (yi or renyi ). For them, good order obtains when “right rules” (yizheng) rather than “might rules” (lizheng) in the world, and “right rules” when agents (both individual and groups) conduct themselves in a manner that is morally right. A way by which we might make sense of the Mohists’ project is to see it as concerned with promoting the public good, where the public good is defined in terms of social and political justice.

Second, Mohist doctrine is almost exclusively concerned with moral behavior rather than moral character  although, to be more precise, the main object of moral evaluation in Mohist doctrine is usually a way of conduct (for the individual) or a policy (for the state), rather than individual acts. In line with this focus on behavior, concepts that are naturally understood to be virtues or desirable qualities of agents (e.g., benevolence and filial piety) in Confucian texts often are discussed as if they are reducible to the moral rightness of conduct. In “Frugality in Funerals,” for instance, “the business of the filial son” is defined in terms of conduct that benefits the world, which is in turn, a criterion of moral rightness (see the next section).

Third, the Mohists see the morally right as conceptually distinct from the customary or traditional. An argument that appeals to the distinction can be found in “Frugality in Funerals.”  The Mohists point to the variety between burial customs among the tribal peoples on the periphery of the Chinese world and note that, although what the tribes practice is customary within their communities, these practices also are all understood by an elite Chinese audience to be barbaric and immoral.  The Mohists thus urge that, just because elaborate funerals and lengthy mourning are customary practices among the gentlemen of the central states, this fact alone will not secure their consistency with moral rightness.

Fourth, for the Mohists, the Way is the subject of explicit expression in the form of “doctrine” (yan).  Before proceeding with this point, it must be stressed that the term yan in the core chapters and other texts contemporary to the period ( the Mencius for instance) is often not best taken as “language” or “speech” in any generic sense. Rather, it often means “doctrine” or “maxim of conduct,” a verbal package meant to guide individual conduct and state policy. In other words, we can take yan in the core chapters as the verbal counterpart to a conception of the Way, a linguistic formula that identifies a Way of life and guiding the conduct of those who hold to it.

Not only are Mozi and the Mohists concerned to advance a Way, they are explicit in verbalizing their Way as doctrine, offering arguments for it and defending it against rival doctrines. In disputation, they often first formulate their rivals’ positions as opposing doctrines before attempting to refute them.  They also often identify rivals by the doctrines they supposedly “hold to” (for instance, they speak of “the doctrine of those who hold to [the thesis that] (“fate exists'” in “Against Fatalism”).  There is even a tendency to see the problematic conduct of people as largely springing from wrong doctrine, quite apart from the concern to offer arguments against various opponent positions. In addition, when the Mohists evaluate a practice or way of conduct, they sometimes speak in terms of evaluating the doctrinethat (putatively) corresponds to that practice (see, for instance, “Frugality in Funerals”).

The “Ten Theses” as a whole can thus be taken as presenting the sum of Mohist doctrine, which is itself the verbal or linguistic counterpart to their Way, their conception of what is morally right. The characteristically Mohist tendency to see the Way as open to linguistic formulation puts them in sharp contrast with “Daoist” traditions such as those associated with Laozi and Zhuangzi. In fact, as Robert Eno has argued, the Mohist focus on doctrine very likely forms the polemical background to the critique against language in texts such as the “Discourse on Making Things Equal” chapter in the Zhuangzi.

5. Moral Epistemology

One of the philosophically most interesting aspects of the Mohist concern with doctrine is their explicit discussion of criteria for evaluating doctrine in the “Against Fatalism” chapters.  The “Three Tests of Doctrine” are introduced as the “standards” or “gnomons” (yi) without which doctrinal disputes become futile. As version C puts it: “To expound doctrine without first establishing standards (yi) is like telling time using a sundial that has been placed on a spinning potter’s wheel.”  The consequence is that the dispute will be interminable.

Although each version of “Against Fatalism” lists three “Tests,” the lists differ and a total of four distinct “Tests” can be identified:

  1. Conformity to the Will of Heaven and the Spirits — this criterion is mentioned only in “Against Fatalism” B but forms the subject matter of the “Heaven’s Will” chapters. In those chapters, we can also find the claim that Heaven’s will is to Mozi like as “the compass is to a wheelwright or the setsquare is to a carpenter.”  Just as the wheelwright and carpenter use these tools to evaluate if some object is properly considered round or square, so Mozi is said to lay down Heaven’s will as a model (fa) and establish it as a standard (yi) by which conduct and doctrines can be evaluated.
  2. Conformity to the teaching and practice of the ancient sage kings — Varieties of this “Test” are reported in all versions of “Against Fatalism” and its application can be seen throughout the core chapters.
  3. Good consequences for the welfare of the world (especially the material wellbeing of the common people understood in terms of them having food, shelter and rest) —  Varieties of this “Test” are also reported in all versions of “Against Fatalism” and a lengthy elaboration can also be found in “Frugality in Funerals.”
  4. Confirmation by the testimony of the masses’ sense of sight and hearing — This “Test” is listed in “Against Fatalism” A and C, and there are only two certain applications” in the core chapters: in the “Elucidating Ghosts” chapter as part of the proof that providential ghosts exist, and in “Against Fatalism” B as part of the argument against the doctrine of fatalism.

There seems to be a widespread temptation to construe the different “Tests” in the following way: if a doctrine (yan) passes a “Test,” it is true. On this interpretation, the third “Test” might suggest a pragmatic conception of truth (or at least a pragmatic conception of the justification of truth claims).  But such a reading is at best underdetermined by the text. It is also unnecessary as long as we keep in mind that the sort of yan at stake in the Core Chapters is usually such doctrine as is meant to guide conduct.

With that background in mind, we can at least see the first three “Tests” as being meant precisely for evaluating such yan as are naturally evaluated in terms of whether they correctly guide human conduct, rather than whether they make a true factual claim.  This means that these “Tests” are best taken as criteria for assessing the soundness of normative rather than descriptive claims.  Now given that Mohist doctrine is meant to be the verbal correlate of their conception of the Way, which in turn can be taken as their conception of what is morally right, it follows that “sound doctrine” in the context of Mohist thought is ultimately doctrine that enjoins morally right conduct and in this specific sense correctly guides human conduct. This also implies that each of these “Tests” can be understood as a criterion for moral rightness.

As for the fourth “Test,” while it seems natural to take it as a criterion for evaluating factual, rather than normative claims, it should still be kept in mind that the Mohists appear to be primarily interested in the normative or policy implications of the (putatively factual) claims involved.

6. The Foundations of Mohist Morality

An intriguing question concerns how the different “Tests of Doctrine” (and thus the criterion of moral rightness to which each corresponds) relate to each other and whether any among them is the ultimate criterion to which the others can be reduced.

Of the three main “Tests,” the second one (conformity to the teaching and practice of the ancient sage kings), is most easily shown to be derivative. The core chapters define the sage (and the related “benevolent man,” which means roughly “ideal ruler” in context) as someone whose business it is to bring about order to the world (“Impartial Concern” A) or to promote the world’s welfare and eliminate things that harm it (“Impartial Concern” B, C, “Frugality in Funerals,” “Against Music”). In “Heaven’s Will,” on the other hand, the ancient sages are cited as examples of those who conducted themselves in accordance with Heaven’s will. In summary, the ancient sages are presented by the Mohists as widely acknowledged exemplars of past rulers who successfully conducted themselves according to the Way, and the very reason why they are acknowledged to be sage kings is precisely because they taught sound doctrine and practiced the Way.

Given the wider cultural setting and prevailing rhetorical conventions, the Mohists’ extensive appeal to the example and authority of the ancient sages is entirely understandable. Whatever their actual attitudes concerning the deeds and writings of the ancient sages as constituting a criterion of sound doctrine, the Mohists present themselves as addressing people who take the moral example of the ancient sages seriously. In this, their rhetorical practices do not differ from those of the Confucians. The two groups even share an overlapping taste in their choice of favored ancient sages: Yao, Shun, Yu, Tang, Wen, and Wu.

This leaves Heaven’s Will and good consequences for the welfare of the world as criteria of sound doctrine. There is a strong tradition of modern interpreters, such as Fung Yu-lan, Angus C. Graham, and Benjamin Schwartz, who see the latter as primary and take Mohist doctrine to exemplify a form of utilitarianism. Other scholars, such as Dennis M. Ahren, David E. Soles, and Augustine Tseu, see the former as suggesting a divine command theory of morality, although this interpretation has been criticized by Kristopher Duda among others.  This controversy is not well framed if it is stated purely in terms of the modern and somewhat alien categories of command theory and utilitarianism (or consequentialism). But this criticism aside, the genuine question remains as to how “Heaven’s Will” and “good consequences” relate to each other as criteria of the morally right.

In favor of the position that the criterion of good consequences is ultimate, it may be pointed out that even within the “Heaven’s Will” chapters, the Mohists argue on the basis that certain ways of conduct are in accordance with Heaven’s Will because they promote the public good. It is further claimed that Heaven desires that people do certain sorts of things or conduct themselves in a certain manner because such conduct will promote the public good, an outcome that Heaven desires. These considerations suggest that the criterion of Heaven’s Will might ultimately be reducible to that of good consequences.

In response, it is at least possible that while the question what ways of conduct are morally right? is always answerable in terms of whether or not a way of conduct promotes good consequences, the separate question of why these ways of conduct (picked out using the criterion of good consequences) are ultimately obligatory is answered with reference to Heaven’s Will.  If this is right, then there is a sense in which the two criteria neither reduce to each other nor potentially conflict, as they answer to different concerns altogether.

In any case, almost all of the Mohists’ proposals are explicitly defended on the basis that adopting them will promote the public good. We might thus modestly conclude that whatever the final status of Heaven’s Will as a criterion of the morally right, good consequences for the world is the operational criterion by which the Mohists evaluate various doctrines and the ways of conduct they verbalize.  This conclusion is lent further support by the fact that Heaven’s Will almost never features as an explicit part of the Mohists’ arguments for their specific proposals outside of the “Heaven’s Will” chapters.

7. Impartial Concern

Whether “Heaven’s will” or “good consequences for the world” forms the ultimate criterion of the morally right, the most salient first-order ethical injunction in Mohist doctrine remains that of “impartial concern” (jian’ai).  This is an injunction that is argued for both on the basis that it exemplifies Heaven’s Will (in the “Heaven’s Will” triad) and that it is conducive to the order and welfare of the world (in the “Impartial Concern” triad). In addition, the presentation of the doctrine (in all versions of “Impartial Concern”) strongly suggests that it is meant to be the panacea for all that is seriously wrong with the world and, to that extent, identifies the main substance of the Mohists’ Way.

As earlier indicated, “impartial concern” might be stated as the injunction that people ought to be concerned for the welfare of others without making distinctions between self and others, associates and strangers. Scrutiny of the core chapters, however, suggests both more and less stringent interpretations of what it entails by way of conduct. At one extreme, the injunction seems to require that people ought (to seek) to benefit strangers as much as they do associates, and others, as much as they do themselves. At the other extreme, it only requires that people refrain from harming strangers as much as they do associates, and others, as much as they do themselves. A third, intermediate possibility says that people ought (to seek) to help strangers with urgent needs as much as they do associates, and others, as much as they do themselves.

The least stringent interpretation is implied by passages (in all versions of “Impartial Concern”) where the injunction is argued for on the basis that adopting it will put a stop to the violent inter-personal and inter-group conflicts that beset the world, since on the Mohist account, it is people’s tendency to act on the basis of a greater regard for their own welfare over that of others, and that of their associates over that of strangers, that led them to have no qualms about benefiting themselves or their own associates at the expense of others and even to do so using violent means. The injunction of “impartial concern” is meant to be a reversal of this tendency. On the other hand, the more demanding interpretations are suggested especially by “Impartial Concern C,” in which it is said that if the doctrine is adopted b people, then not only will people not fight, the welfare of the weak and disadvantaged will be taken care of by those better endowed.

Whichever interpretation is taken, the basic injunction points toward an underlying notion of impartiality. We can take “impartial concern” as making explicit the notion that the common benefit of the world is, in some sense, impartially the benefit of everyone.

In “Impartial Concern” C, the Mohists put forward an interesting thought experiment ostensibly to show that even people who are committed to being more concerned for the welfare of self that for that of others, and associates than strangers have some reason to value impartial concern. They described a scenario in which the audience is asked to imagine that they are about to go on a long journey and need to put their family members in the care of another.  The Mohists claim that the obvious and rational choice would be to put one’s family members in the care of an impartialist rather than a partialist (that is, someone who is committed to “impartial concern” as opposed to someone who is committed to the opposite).

There are several problems with this argument. It seems to involve a false dilemma since the options of impartialist and partialist hardly exhaust the range of possible choices.  Even if the Mohists were correct to claim that the impartialist is the obvious and rational choice, all it shows is that partialists have good reason to prefer that other people conduct themselves according to the dictates of impartial concern, rather than that they have reason to so conduct themselves, as Chad Hansen and Bryan W. Van Norden have pointed out.  In defense of the Mohists, however, it might be the case that they are ultimately only concerned to establish that even partialists have reason to propagate the Mohists’ doctrine of impartial concern, a conclusion that could follow from their argument.

8. Moral Psychology and Human Nature

Mohist doctrine as it is presented in the core chapters does not contain explicit discussions of the psychological aspects of the ethical life.  “Human nature” (xing), a term that plays an important role in the thinking of the Confucian thinkers Mencius and Xunzi, as well as Yang Zhu, does not even appear in the core chapters. Nonetheless, various aspects of Mohist doctrine might well entail commitments to potentially controversial positions in moral psychology and the theory of human nature.

Consider the Mohists’ reply to the main objection raised against their doctrine of “impartial concern” — that the doctrine is overly demanding, given that people in general just do not have the motivational resources to act according to its dictates (“Impartial Concern” B and C). Citing historical accounts, the Mohists respond that the requirements of “impartial concern” are no harder than the sorts of things that rulers in the past had been able to demand and get from their subjects, such as reducing one’s diet, wearing coarse clothing, and charging into flames at the ruler’s command. It was because the rulers delighted in such actions and offered suitable incentives to encourage them that they were done, even on a regular basis. The Mohists conclude that people in general can be made to practice “impartial concern” as long as rulers delight in it and offer the right incentives to encourage it.

On the basis of passages such as this one, David S. Nivison and Bryan W. Van Norden argue that either the Mohists held the view that human nature is infinitely malleable or they thought that there is no human nature. Such a reading focuses on the extravagant claim made in the text that as long as the rulers delight in “impartial concern” and offer the right incentives, human beings (especially the structure of their motivations) can be radically changed “within a single generation.”  While this interpretation certainly is compatible with the tenor of the text, it is not necessarily the only possible interpretation.  After all, all that is needed for the Mohists to make their reply is the thought that people — given their nature — can be made to practice “impartial concern” through offering them the right leadership and incentives. They hardly need the stronger (and less plausible) claim that people can be remolded in any fashion whatsoever given the right leadership and incentives. Furthermore, at least some of the historical examples cited by the Mohists suggest that they are thinking more of the people responding to incentives in the environment (e.g., the comfort-loving courtier wearing coarse clothing or going on a diet so as to please the ruler) rather than more radical changes to the structure of their motivations (as might be suggested by the story of the soldiers who have been conditioned to charge into flames on the ruler’s command).

A weaker and to that extent more defensible interpretation is that the Mohists do not consider the Way in a Mencian sense — as “the realization of certain inclinations that human beings already share,” as Shun Kwong-loi puts it. To be more precise, the Mohists do not appear to have considered the inclinations and predispositions that people already have as pointing to the contents of the Way. But they need not deny that these inclinations might, under suitable conditions (e.g., under a suitable regime of incentives), furnish the motivational resources for an agent to conduct himself well (the “Mohist” Yi Zhi in Mencius 3A5 seems to have taken a version of such a position) — as long as it is recalled that what counts as “conducting oneself well” is given by something else other than those inclinations or their development: sound doctrine established by rational arguments. Seen this way, the Mohists would be in direct opposition to Mencius, insofar as Mencius regards those “inclinations that human beings already share” (explicitly construed within the context of an account of human nature) as providing both the contents of morality and the motivational resources for moral cultivation.

9. Government

The Mohists’ political ideal is most prominently stated in the “Elevating the Worthy” and “Exalting Unity” chapters, which include the only theses that are explicitly said to identify “fundamentals of governance” (wei zheng zhi ben).

The “Exalting Unity” triad of chapters contains a “state of nature” argument that bears comparison both with ideas found in the Confucian philosopher Xunzi and perhaps more remotely, Thomas Hobbes’ Leviathan and the social contract tradition of early modern European thought. As with the latter, it is at least arguable that even though the account is couched as if making historical claims about how human beings were like in a distant past “before there were any laws and criminal punishment” (version A) or “before there were rulers or leaders” (versions B and C), its logic is better appreciated if taken as a thought experiment of what things would be like were certain hypothetical conditions to hold.

The most important implications of such a hypothesis, for the Mohists, is that people will hold to different and conflicting opinions about what is morally right (yi), on the basis of which they will condemn each other. The end result is a state of violent conflict and chaos. This chaos is fully resolved only with the installment of a hierarchy of rulers and leaders consistently enforcing a unified conception of what is morally right through surveillance and incentives. The conclusion of the argument is that such a solution is a necessary condition for social and political order.

The “Elevating the Worthy” triad of chapters, on the other hand, proposes that good governance requires that the state cultivate worthy and capable people and employ them as officials, whatever their social origin. This doctrine opposes a form of meritocracy to the nepotism and cronyism prevalent among the rulers. It also insists that if the doctrine is to be successfully carried though, the rulers need to confer high rank, generous stipend and real power upon the worthy. Interestingly, in arguing for the doctrine, version B both traces it to the practices of the ancient sage kings and also says that the ancients were modeling their regime upon Heaven, thus suggesting that an application of the criterion of “Heaven’s will” in involved. Nonetheless, the main thrust of all three versions remains that meritocracy will bring great benefits to the state.

10. Frugality

Three of the ten core Mohist theses are related to the virtue of frugality: “Frugality in Expenditures,” “Frugality in Funerals,” and “Against Music.”  For the most part, the arguments in these chapters are paradigmatic cases of “good consequences to the welfare of the world” as criterion of the morally right. (As mentioned earlier, a lengthy elaboration of the criterion can be found in the opening parts of “Frugality in Funerals.”) In “Frugality in Expenditures,” the criterion is applied positively through showing that the preferred policy of government thrift brings about beneficial consequences. In the other two triads, the criterion is applied negatively through detailing the harmful consequences that attend elaborate funerals and prolonged mourning, and extravagant music displays of the aristocracy.

One interesting feature of the arguments in these chapters is the weight given to the welfare of the common people in the Mohists’ calculation of the benefit and harm that result from the policy under assessment. This aspect of Mohist doctrine is especially prominent in “Against Music,” where a large part of what counts as the “good consequences” of a policy is articulated in terms of the common people receiving enough to eat, being protected from the elements and having sufficient rest. It thus seems that, despite their commitment to “impartial concern,” the Mohists have a partisan concern for the interests of the lower social classes. The more charitable interpretation, however, is that they are accommodating concerns in the region of distributive justice. That is, the common benefit of the world is in some sense impartially and equally the benefit of everyone; but since the Mohists — like most thinkers in ancient China — do not envision a radical elimination of the vast social, economic and political inequalities that are simply a fact of life in Warring States China, the distributive concerns are met by giving extra weight to the interests of the disadvantaged. This reading is also consonant with their claim that were “impartial concern” to be widely practice, the welfare of the weak and disadvantaged will be taken care of by those better endowed (in “Impartial Concern C”).

A more serious charge against the Mohists, however, is that their doctrine on frugality commits them to an overly restrictive and hence highly implausible conception of the good. The Confucian thinker Xunzi defends elaborate Confucian funeral rituals and musical displays against Mohist attacks by claiming that they given form to, and meet, the emotional needs of people. Conversely, Mohist doctrine simply fails to take into account aspects of the human good not reducible to material livelihood. Insofar as Mohist doctrine does imply such a reduced conception of the human good, this is a cogent objection.

But insofar as the main weight of the Mohist arguments lies in the thought that it is unjust of the aristocrats to provide for their own emotional needs (through elaborate funerals and prolonged mourning) or refined enjoyment (though elaborate musical displays) through an imposition upon the labor of the common people, the objection is not decisive. Interestingly enough, that this what the Mohists have in mind is indicated in “Against Music.” The text apologizes for attacking the aristocracy’s musical displays by conceding that while music and other refinements are “delightful,” they bring no benefit to the common people and, in fact, harm their livelihood.

11. Just War

The Mohists reserved some of their most trenchant condemnations against military aggression, asserting that offensive war is harmful to the welfare of the world and contrary to Heaven’s will. One argument (two variations of which can be found in “Against Military Aggression” A and “Heaven’s Will” C) proceeds by claiming that there is an analogy between the actions of a military aggressor and those of people who steal or rob others or who murder. And since (as even the audience agrees) stealing, robbing and murdering are morally wrong, and since actions that cause greater harm to others are, to that extent, greater wrongs, military aggression is a great wrong indeed.

Another series of arguments (in “Against Military Aggression” B and C) proceeds by pointing out in some detail the economic and human cost of military aggression even to the aggressors. To the reply that some of the Warring States appear to have greatly profited from their aggressive ways, the Mohists point out that they are the rare exceptions and seeking profit by such means is tantamount to calling a medication effective that cured four or five out of myriads.

Perhaps as befits the difference in addressee, the second set of arguments appears more pragmatic as it appeals to the “war-loving” rulers’ sense of self-interest. The earlier argument, on the other hand, appears to aim showing the gentlemen of the world that they ought to condemn military aggression if they are to be consistent with their own normative convictions — if they know that stealing, robbing and murdering is wrong and blameworthy, they ought also to consider military aggression wrong and blameworthy.

The objection is raised in “Against Military Aggression” C that the ancient sage kings waged war, and since they are supposed to be models of moral rectitude, it follows that war cannot be unqualifiedly wrong. In response, the Mohists introduce a distinction between justified and unjustified warfare, claiming that the former was waged by the righteous ancient sage rulers to overthrow evil tyrants. The precise criterion of the distinction between the two forms of warfare, however, is not explicitly spelled out in that chapter. Instead, justified warfare is associated with supernatural signs indicating that Heaven has given the ruler a mandate to wage war so as to visit condign punishment upon some wicked tyrant. This is surprising since elsewhere (“Impartial Concern” C), the Mohists present the sage Yu’s military campaigns to pacify the unruly Miao tribes as an example of his “impartial concern” for the welfare of the people of the world. This suggests that there are ample resources within Mohist doctrine to spell out the distinction in less exotic terms. But since they did connect the distinction between justified and unjustified warfare to Heaven and the spirits, a discussion of the Mohists’ religious views is in order.

12. Heaven and Spirits

Within the core chapters, the Mohists consistently portray Heaven as if it possesses personal characteristics and exists separately from human beings, though intervening in their affairs. In particular, they present Heaven if it is an entity having will and desire, and concerned about the welfare of the people of the world, even a providential agent that rewards the just and punishes the wicked through its control of natural phenomena or by means of its superhuman intermediaries, the spirits (guishen). Finally, Heaven and the spirits are also portrayed as the objects of reverence, sacrificial offerings and supplication (“Heaven’s Will” B).

Apart from the earlier mentioned role of Heaven’s will in providing a criterion for what is morally right, the Mohists also blame people’s loss of belief in the existence, power and providential character of spirits for the perceived immorality and chaos of their time. This motivates them to argue that such spirits do exist in “Elucidating the Spirits.”  But the Mohists’ considered position with regards to the existence of providential spirits as opposed to the usefulness of a widespread belief in their existence is an ambiguous one at best. While the first parts of “Elucidating the Spirits” seem aimed at establishing that the spirits exist (by appealing to the testimony of people sense of sight and hearing), the bulk of the arguments in the chapter are better taken as attempts to show that it is socially and politically beneficial that people in general believe in the existence of providential spirits and that the government organize its affairs on the basis that they exist. As the text puts it:

If the fact that ghosts and spirits reward the worthy and punish the evil can be made a cornerstone of policy in the state and impressed upon the common people, it will provide a means to bring order to the state and benefit to the people.

In this regard, an argument that appears towards the end of the chapter is most telling. To the objection that the doctrine on spirits entails the need to sacrifice to them, which in turn interferes with one’s duties towards one’s living parents, the Mohists reply that if the spirits do exist, then the sacrifices cannot be considered a waste of resources; but if they do not exist, then the community can still come together to share in the communion of the sacrificial wine and millet and the sacrifice will still serve a socially useful function. The argument implies that what the Mohists are ultimately concerned to argue for is neutral with respect to whether or not providential spirits actually exist, as the author and Benjamin Wong have pointed out.

13. References and Further Reading

  • Ahern, Dennis M. “Is Mo Tzu a Utilitarian?” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 3 (1976): 185-193.
  • Duda, Kristopher. “Reconsidering Mo Tzu on the Foundations of Morality.” Asian Philosophy 11/1 (2001): 23-31.
  • Fung Yu-lan. A History of Chinese Philosophy. 2 vols. Trans. Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1952-53.
  • Graham, Angus C. Divisions in Early Mohism Reflected in the Core Chapters of Mo-tzu. Singapore: Institute of East Asian Philosophies, 1985.
  • Graham, Angus C. Later Mohist Logic, Ethics, and Science. Hong Kong: Chinese University Press / London: School of Oriental and African Studies, 1978; reprinted 2003.
  • Hansen, Chad. A Daoist Theory of Chinese Thought: A Philosophical Interpretation. New York: Oxford University Press, 1992.
  • Hsiao Kung-chuan. A History of Chinese Political Thought, Vol. 1: From the Beginnings to the Sixth Century A. D. Trans. F. W. Mote. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1979.
  • Hu Shih. The Development of the Logical Method in Ancient China. 2nd edition. New York: Paragon Book Reprint Corp., 1963.
  • Ivanhoe, Philip J. “Mohist Philosophy.”  In Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ed.  Edward Craig (London and New York: Routledge, 1998), 6:451-458.
  • Knoblock, John, trans.  Xunzi: A Translation and Study of the Complete Works. 3 vols. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1988-94.
  • Lai, Whalen. “The Public Good that does the Public Good: A New Reading of Mohism.” Asian Philosophy 3/2 (1993): 125-141.
  • Lowe, Scott. Mo Tzu’s Religious Blueprint for a Chinese Utopia: The Will and the Way. Ontario: Edwin Mellen Press, 1992.
  • Loy, Hui-chieh. “On a Gedankenexperiment in the Mozi Core Chapters.” Oriens Extremus 45 (2005): 141-158.
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Author Information

Hui-chieh Loy
Email: philoyhc@nus.edu.sg
National University of Singapore
Singapore

Concepts

Concepts are of central importance to an overall theory of cognition and the mind. Our thoughts, especially those that express or involve propositions, are analyzed and distinguished from one another by appeal to various facts involving concepts and our grasp of them. Similarly, our linguistic utterances that express propositions also express concepts, since concepts are normally thought to be closely related to, or even identified with, the meanings of entities like predicates, adjectives, and the like. Our understanding and interaction with the world also involves concepts and our grasp of them. Our understanding that a given thing is a member of a given category is at least partly in virtue of our grasp of concepts, and so are our acts of categorizing. Such capacities involve our knowledge in an essential way, and thus such philosophical issues regarding our epistemic capacities are tied to issues about concepts and their nature. There may be some features and capacities of the mind that do not involve concepts, but certainly the vast number of them do, and thus the task of identifying the correct general theory of concepts is significant to the philosophy of mind, philosophy of language, cognitive science, and psychology.

After an introduction listing many of the more significant philosophical questions concerning concepts, the article provides a detailed list of goals for an overall or complete theory of concepts, sorted according to tasks related to the metaphysics, analysis, and epistemology of concepts. The article also gives a detailed exposition of the main theories of concepts that have been proposed, along with some of the more important objections that have been raised in criticism of each. An annotated bibliography is at the end.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Tasks for an Overall Theory of Concepts
    1. The Metaphysics of Concepts
    2. Analysis of Concepts
    3. The Epistemology of Concepts
  3. Theories of Concepts
    1. The Classical Theory, or Definitionism
    2. Neoclassical Theories
    3. Prototype/Exemplar Theories
    4. Theory-theories
    5. Atomistic Theories
  4. Conclusion
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

What is a concept? When one utters the sentence “Polaris is a star,” the meaning of that sentence is the proposition that Polaris is a star. Alternatively, one’s utterance of that sentence expresses the proposition that Polaris is a star. But in doing so, one also expresses the concept of being a star, the reason being that the predicate ‘is a star’ expresses that concept. Similarly, my belief that Polaris is a star in some sense involves the proposition that Polaris is a star, and part of the content of that proposition is the concept [star] (where the notation ‘[F]’ in what follows signifies the concept of being (an) F). But what is the concept of being a star? This general question raises a host of other questions. For instance: Is there just one concept of being a star, or do individual agents have their own concepts of being a star that might be distinct from one another? Is a concept a mental particular, such as a particular idea in one’s mind? Or are concepts not mental entities at all? Might the concept of being a star instead be something such as the predicate ‘is a star’? Or perhaps the set of stars themselves? Or is the concept of being a star an abstract entity in some sense? And if so, what sort of abstract entity is it? And what makes the concept of being a star distinct from other concepts?

These are metaphysical questions. But there are epistemological questions about concepts as well. For instance, concepts seem to be the sorts of things that get grasped, possessed, or understood in coming to have beliefs (and ultimately knowledge) about the world. But the nature of concept possession is itself a bit mysterious. Is there just one way to possess a given concept, or might there be many such ways? Does possession of the concept of being a star require some sort of complete understanding of that concept or not? And how does one first come to grasp the concept of being a star? Finally, various sorts of behavior seem to be explained in terms of one’s grasp of concepts. For instance, one can consider Polaris, the sun, Jupiter, and the Andromeda galaxy, and one can categorize those things as being stars or not. Performing such sorting behavior accurately is a prerequisite for various sorts of knowledge, thus categorization is of interest to philosophers working in epistemology, and explaining how such behavior happens is of interest to psychologists. Categorization seems to have something to do with one’s grasp of the concept of being a star, but what is the relationship between that ability, the grasping of that concept, and the nature of that concept in itself?

2. Tasks for an Overall Theory of Concepts

As the preceding questions imply, there are a wide variety of tasks for an overall theory of concepts to accomplish. Various theories of concepts handle some of them, but few claim to handle them all. But what should such an overall theory of concepts provide? The question is a useful one for three reasons: First, answering it will make as clear as possible just what issues about concepts a given view addresses and which it does not. Thus it will be clearer what else must be added to the view in question in order to provide a complete account of concepts. Second, the demands on a theory of concepts are logically related to each other, and such relationships themselves serve to raise problems for various candidate theories of concepts. For instance, a Platonistic view of the metaphysics of concepts takes concepts to be abstract entities that are neither physical nor spatiotemporal. But such a metaphysical commitment as to the nature of concepts has consequences with respect to the right conditions on concept possession. For instance, one sort of objection faced by a Platonist is that Platonism about concepts would render concepts unpossessible. That is, if concepts are nonspatiotemporal, it is difficult to see how beings like ourselves could ever be related to concepts in such a way as to possess or understand them. So identifying at least some of the requirements on an overall theory of concepts makes the task of evaluating a given view of concepts easier. If a view of concepts is such that it would then be impossible to satisfy one or more of the other requirements of an overall theory of concepts, then the view fails. Finally, if there are candidate requirements on an overall theory of concepts that turn out on further inspection not to be requirements of such a theory at all, then no theory of concepts should be faulted for failing to satisfy that requirement.

At least some of the following general requirements have been proposed (and see also Rey 1983/1999 and Prinz 2002, Ch. 1 for similar lists). A complete theory of concepts should provide:

An account of the metaphysics of concepts

  • An answer to the problem of universals, treating the problem of what concepts are as a special case
  • An account of concepts as universals with concepts distinguished from other sorts of universals
  • An account of the identity conditions for concepts
  • An account of the distinction between simple and complex concepts

An account of analysis for concepts

  • An account of the satisfaction conditions for being in the possible-worlds extension of a given concept
  • An account of logical constitution for concepts
  • An account of the distinction between primitive and complex concepts
  • Specific conditions on correct analyses

An account of the epistemology of concepts

  • An account of concept possession
  • An account of concept acquisition
  • An account of categorization

The following sections are devoted to a more detailed discussion of the requirements themselves.

a. The Metaphysics of Concepts

Metaphysical issues involving concepts include what their status is as universals (and also as distinct from other sorts of universals), whether they are mind-dependent or mind-independent entities, what their identity conditions are, and whether they are metaphysically simple or complex.

First, concepts are universals. Distinct verbal expressions (such as distinct predicates, for instance) may nevertheless express the same concept. For instance, ‘is red’ in English and ‘ist Rot’ in German are distinct predicates that express the same concept. Similarly, ‘is the author of The Firm’ and ‘is The Firm’s author’ seem to express the same concept. Predicates that necessarily refer to all of the same things, such as ‘is an equiangular triangle’ and ‘is an equilateral triangle’, are more controversial examples. So are pairs of expressions related by the analysis relation, such as ‘brother’ and ‘male sibling’. The public character of concepts is further evidence that concepts are universals. That is, concepts can be understood by different agents, so it seems that the very same concept can be represented in many different minds at once, much as pain (a type of mental state) can be had by many different agents at the same time. Even if each agent has a pain that is her own, there is still something that all of those agents share—they all are in pain. Similarly for concepts—there is something we all share in virtue of possessing the concept of being a star, for instance, even if precisely speaking, what is present in each of our minds may not be exactly the same. Finally, concepts typically may have multiple “exemplifications” or “instances” across possible worlds, and this is also evidence that concepts are universals. There are many instances of the concept of being a star, for instance, since there are many stars. Hence the so-called “problem of universals” applies to concepts, and a complete account of concepts must defend some theory of universals with respect to them. (It is noteworthy that some authors, e.g., Prinz 2002, reject the notion that concepts serve as linguistic meanings, focusing instead on other functions that concepts have been invoked to serve. Yet even if concepts are not identical to linguistic meanings of some kind, the publicity and multiple-exemplifiability of concepts serves as evidence that they are universals.)

As with other universals (such as properties, relations, and propositions), the available theories include various versions of realism and nominalism. Realism about concepts is the view that concepts are distinct from their instances, and nominalism is the view that concepts are nothing over and above, or distinct from, their instances. Ante rem realism (or Platonism) about concepts is the view that concepts are ontologically prior to their instances—that is, concepts exist whether they have instances or not. In re realism about concepts is the view that concepts are in some sense “in” their instances, and thus are not ontologically prior to their instances. Conceptualism with respect to concepts holds that concepts are mental entities, being either immanent in the mind itself as a sort of idea, as constituents of complete thoughts, or somehow dependent on the mind for their existence (perhaps by being possessed by an agent or by being possessible by an agent). Conceptualist views also include imagism, the view (dating from Locke and others) that concepts are a sort of mental image. Finally, nominalist views of concepts might identify concepts with classes or sets of particular things (with the concept [star] identified with the set of all stars, or perhaps the set of all possible stars). Linguistic nominalism identifies concepts with the linguistic expressions used to express them (with the concept [star] identified with the predicate ‘is a star’, perhaps). Type linguistic nominalism identifies concepts with types of verbal expressions (with the concept [star] identified with the type of verbal expression exemplified by the predicate ‘is a star’). (Platonists about concepts would of course include Plato himself, and modern Platonists include both Chisholm 1996 and Bealer 1993. Aristotle is the most well-known in re realist, though it is somewhat unclear what his view of concepts, construed as linguistic meanings, would be. Most of the early moderns, including Locke, Berkeley, and Hume, seem to espouse some version of conceptualism, and the views of most contemporary cognitive scientists and psychologists imply a commitment to either conceptualism or some sort of nominalism. Quine 1953, 1960 is one of the more recognizable nominalists about universals, though he is also a skeptic about linguistic meaning generally.)

The different options as to the metaphysical status of concepts can also be sorted out depending on the view’s take on the question of whether concepts are mind-dependent or not. On many views, and in fact according to nearly all views held in psychology and cognitive science, concepts are things that are “in” the mind, or “part of” the mind, or at least are dependent for their existence on the mind in some sense. Other views deny such claims, holding instead that concepts are mind-independent entities. Conceptualist views are examples of the former view, and Platonistic and some nominalistic views are examples of the latter view. The issue of the mind-dependence of concepts carries a great deal of importance with respect to which (if any) of the currently available views of concepts is correct. For instance, if concepts are immanent in the mind as particular mental representations of some category or other, and if those representations can be shown not to be analyzed in terms of necessary and sufficient defining conditions, then the classical view of concepts (or definitionism) is undermined; yet if concepts exist independently of one’s ideas, beliefs, capacities for categorizing objects, and so on, then empirical evidence concerning our categorization behavior, early childhood mental development, etc. is of much less consequence with respect to the question of what concepts themselves are. Such evidence might be of great importance to theorizing about our grasp or understanding of concepts, but not as important to the metaphysics of concepts themselves.

The distinctions above can cut across one another. For instance, one might borrow Fodor’s (1975) idea that there is a “language of thought” whereby thoughts are structured just as sentences are, and follow the very same sorts of grammatical rules that spoken languages do, and treat concepts accordingly. One could take concepts to be “in the mind,” and also as being identical to types of linguistic representations. The resulting view would be an example of type linguistic nominalism that nevertheless treats concepts as in the mind, and thus as essentially mind-dependent.

Still another task for an overall theory of concepts is to distinguish concepts from other sorts of universals, and the most straightforward way of doing this is to provide an account of the identity conditions for concepts. For example, if it turns out that concepts and properties have different identity conditions, then they must be distinct sorts of entities. And providing an account of the identity conditions for concepts is necessary for another reason too. If concepts are taken to be linguistic meanings, then some account must be given for what holds true when two distinct verbal expressions express the same concept, as well as what holds true when two verbal expressions do not express the same concept. An account of the identity conditions for concepts would be of great assistance here. As a final matter of significance with respect to the metaphysics of concepts, it might be wondered whether concepts are themselves simple or complex. Are concepts “unstructured” entities without proper parts, or are they complexes of simpler entities? As with the other metaphysical requirements on an overall theory of concepts, there are a number of options to pursue. The distinction is considered further below.

b. Analysis of Concepts

Concepts also seem to be the targets of analysis. One of the traditional tasks of analytic philosophy is that of providing analyses of concepts, but an important question is that of what an analysis itself is, and whether or not there are such things.

At the very least, an analysis of a concept should specify the conditions satisfied by those things that are instances of that concept—an analysis of [star] should say what makes a star a star. One might call such conditions the metaphysical satisfaction conditions for concepts, where such conditions specify all possible conditions on which the concept being analyzed would apply. Such conditions specify the “possible-worlds extension” of a concept, namely a set of things, ranging across all possible circumstances, to which that concept would apply. (Note that such a set of conditions might differ from what an agent believes the satisfaction conditions of a given concept to be, and both sets of conditions might vary from what an agent might use to sort or categorize things as being instances of that concept or not.) Specification of such metaphysical satisfaction conditions is necessary for providing an account of the identity conditions for concepts. For example, if two predicate expressions differ in their possible-worlds extension, then the concepts expressed by those predicates must be distinct. And in order for two predicate expressions to express the same concept, they must share the same possible-worlds extension. So analyses should provide the metaphysical satisfaction conditions for the concept being analyzed. There may be many ways of accomplishing such a task. For one might provide such conditions in terms of lists of necessary conditions (as the classical theory of concepts does), in terms of lists of “weighted” typical features (as prototype views of concepts seem to do), in terms of lists of individually necessary conditions that are not jointly sufficient (as neoclassical views do), etc.

Another way of putting this general point about analyses is that analyses specify a logical constitution for the concept being analyzed. For instance, a classical analysis accomplishes this in virtue of specifying a number of concepts related by entailment or logical consequence to the concept being analyzed, and that collection of concepts is a logical constitution for the concept being analyzed. To say that concepts are related by entailment is just to say the following: For the concepts expressed by the predicate expressions ‘is an F’ and ‘is a G’, if the sentence “For all x, if x is an F then x is a G” is a necessary truth, then the concept of being an F entails the concept of being a G. The classical view is committed to this sort of relation holding between a concept to be analyzed and individual concepts included in a logical constitution for that concept—for instance, if a correct analysis of [star] includes being a celestial body as a necessary condition, then something’s being a star logically entails that it is a celestial body.

Do other views of concepts share the classical view’s claim that concepts have logical constitutions? Certainly neoclassical views do, for so long as a given neoclassical view holds that concepts have necessary conditions (no matter what they say about sufficient conditions), such a view claims that there are entailment relations between something’s being an instance of a given concept and that thing’s satisfying the necessary conditions for being an instance of that concept. What of prototype views? Such theorists usually speak fairly strongly against concepts having conceptual analyses, but in the classical sense. But such views could hold a different view of analysis, where such a view holds that concepts have logical constitutions, but the logical relationship between the concept being analyzed and the concepts in its constitution is a statistical relation, rather than entailment. Finally, atomistic views of concepts have a thesis with respect to the logical constitution of concepts: Such views claim that there are no such logical relations among concepts at all. But even so, one still faces the task of defending a thesis with respect to whether complex concepts have logical constitutions or not. And if one does claim that concepts have logical constitutions, one must defend a claim as to the nature of those logical relations between complex concepts and the members of their logical constitutions.

If at least some concepts have logical constituents, then there must be some stock of concepts that are such that they have no logical constituents themselves. That is, there must be some stock of concepts that might appear in the analyses of various complex concepts, but have no analyses themselves. One then wonders what sort of character such primitive concepts have. Various empiricist philosophers (such as Locke and Hume, for instance) have held that primitive concepts are derived immediately from sensation, and thus that all complex concepts are such that their full analyses (all the way down to the primitives) are in terms of sense impressions only. Other views might include such a story for some concepts, but add that there are other primitive concepts not derived from sense impressions. For instance, the concepts of justice and goodness may well be analyzable, but not fully in terms of sense impressions. Various other concepts in philosophy and mathematics have been offered as other candidates, such as the concepts of belief, mind, free action, truth, inference, set, function, and number. What primitive concepts such complex concepts might ultimately be analyzable in terms of, if not in terms of sense impressions, remains something of a mystery. Also mysterious is how one might grasp such primitive concepts initially, especially if one seeks to avoid commitments to innate possession of such concepts.

There are thus two different distinctions having to do with conceptual “complexity,” one being a metaphysical distinction and the other being a logical one. For there is a difference between claiming that a given concept has proper parts (or literal constituents) and claiming that a given concept has logical constituents (or that there are other concepts logically related to that concept). For a view taking concepts to be mental particulars, such a view might hold that even primitive concepts (that is, those having no analyses) nevertheless have proper parts. For instance, physicalists about such mental particulars might nevertheless hold that primitive concepts nevertheless have physical parts that are not themselves concepts. Such concepts would be complex in the metaphysical sense, but not in the logical sense. In contrast, other theories of concepts might take all concepts to be metaphysically simple (with no proper parts), while still taking some concepts to have logical constitutions and some not. Views taking concepts to be abstract, Platonistic entities seem to fall into this category. So there are two different distinctions here that need not coincide. For lack of a better term, one might use ‘complex’ in both distinctions: A concept may be complex in the metaphysical sense (as opposed to its being metaphysically simple), and/or it may be complex in the sense that it has logical constituents (as opposed to its being primitive, or its having no logical constituents). A complete theory of concepts would provide clear accounts of both distinctions, along with which concepts fall into which category.

One final issue concerning analysis is that no matter what view of analysis one holds, one must specify what it is for a candidate analysis to be a correct analysis. But what are the truth-conditions for analyses? For instance, the classical theory of concepts holds that correct classical analyses will have no possible counterexamples. Other views of analysis might share this basic idea, but defenders of such other views would need to give some account of the truth-conditions of analyses in order to state their position in a complete way. On a prototype view of concepts, one would deny that concepts have classical-style analyses, but perhaps “analyze” a given complex concept in terms of features likely to be had by instances of that concept instead. A correct analysis of the concept [bird], then, would include features that really are typical of, or likely to be had by, instances of that concept.

c. The Epistemology of Concepts

Various views on the nature of concepts have been invoked in order to answer a host of questions in epistemology, where such questions are epistemic in the sense that they are tied to questions ultimately about knowledge, belief, and justification. For instance, what propositional knowledge one is capable of attaining seems dependent on what concepts one possesses—one cannot know that the sun is a star unless one can have the thought that the sun is a star, and one cannot have that thought unless one possesses the concept [star]. Moreover, one’s abilities to sort things into different categories seem dependent on what concepts one possesses. One cannot reliably sort red things from yellow things, in the sense of doing so on the basis of knowing the difference between them, unless one possesses the concepts [red] and [yellow]. But in order to provide complete and correct accounts of the contents of one’s thoughts, as well as accounting for cognitive abilities relevant to having knowledge, one needs an account of concept possession, or an account of what it is to grasp, understand, or at least have some understanding of a given concept. Furthermore, a complete account of concept possession should have something to say about how concepts are acquired or “learned” for the first time. For if learning new things about the world at least in some cases involves acquiring new concepts, some account of concept acquisition is necessary for giving a proper account of knowledge acquisition as a whole. So what is desirable of a complete theory of concepts is not only an account of what concepts are in themselves but also an account of what it is to possess or understand them. (See Rey 1983; Peacocke 1989a, 1989b, and 1992; and Bealer 1998 for discussion by philosophers about concept possession, and Rosch 1999, Smith and Medin 1981, and Murphy 2002 for discussion by psychologists.)

3. Theories of Concepts

At least five general theories of concepts have been proposed: The classical theory, which takes concepts to be analyzed in terms of necessary and jointly sufficient conditions; neoclassical theories, which hold that concepts have necessary conditions, but denies that all concepts have individually necessary conditions that are jointly sufficient; prototype theories, which take concepts to be accounted for in terms of lists of typical features (instead of metaphysically necessary conditions) or in terms of paradigm cases or exemplars; theory-theories, which take concepts to be entities individuated by the roles they play in internally represented “mental” theories (where such a theory is immanent in the mind and of some category or other); and atomistic theories, which take most concepts to be primitive unanalyzable entities.

It should be stressed that the theories presently available have not been put forth as purporting to be complete theories of concepts, in the sense that none of them aim to answer all of the questions listed earlier under the heading of tasks for an overall theory of concepts. For instance, prototype views seem focused most sharply on epistemic concerns related to concept possession more than the task of answering questions about the metaphysics of concepts or about the analysis of them. Classical views of concepts give an account of conceptual analysis primarily, and do not usually include accounts of concept possession as well, though some theorists sympathetic to the classical view (such as Peacocke 1992) espouse a theory of concept possession too. The material below contains summaries of the basic tenets of each view, along with some of the more significant objections to each. Possible replies to the objections have been omitted on the grounds of keeping the presentation brief, though they may be found in the materials listed in the references at the end of the article.

a. The Classical Theory, or Definitionism

The classical theory of concepts holds that complex concepts have classical analyses, where such an analysis is a proposition that gives a set of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for being in the possible-worlds extension of the concept being analyzed. To put the matter a slightly different way, the classical view holds that concepts have logical constitutions, which are collections of concepts that are related by entailment to the concept being analyzed. For instance, the concept of being unmarried belongs to a logical constitution of the concept of being a bachelor, in part because something’s being a bachelor entails its being unmarried. To speak of a logical constitution rather than the logical constitution seems necessary since there may be many different analyses of the same concept—e.g., correct analyses of [square] are expressed by “A square is a closed four-sided figure, with sides of equal lengths and neighboring sides orthogonal to each other” and “A square is a four-sided regular figure.” A classical analysis is then a proposition that specifies such a logical constitution by specifying individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions. Some would call such a proposition a definition, though one might use a more refined term and call them classical definitions, since there seem to be many sorts of definitions (e.g., partial definitions, ostensive definitions, procedural definitions, etc.).

One discovers such analyses by the method most famously used by Socrates in Platonic dialogues like the Euthyphro, Lysis and Laches, which seek to find the nature of piety, friendship, and courage, respectively. The method is to consider a candidate analysis of a given concept, with the intent of seeking counterexamples to that analysis. If there are such counterexamples, then the candidate analysis is false, and if there are no possible counterexamples to that analysis, then it is correct. For instance, take the following candidate analysis of the concept of being a square: A square is a four-sided figure. This analysis is inadequate (it is too broad), since a rectangle with neighboring sides of different lengths is a four-sided figure, and yet not a square. Such a figure is a counterexample to the candidate analysis under consideration. Counterexamples can also show a candidate analysis to be too narrow. For instance, take the candidate analysis expressed by “A bachelor is an unmarried male under age 70.” Surely there are some octogenarians who are bachelors, and any of them would count as a counterexample to the candidate analysis. It is the seeking of both sorts of counterexamples that characterizes the seeking of classical analyses.

The quest for classical-style analyses is common in the philosophical literature of the past two and a half millennia, and the classical theory of concepts was in fact the dominant view up to the last half of the Twentieth Century. Examples of classical analyses include Aristotle’s account of definitions themselves as “an account [or logos] that signifies the essence (Topics I),” where “the essence” of something is given in terms of essential or necessary features. Other well-known examples of classical analyses include Descartes’ definition of body as that which is extended in both space and time, Locke’s definition of being free with respect to a given action as being such that one performs that action, chooses or wills that action, and that had one chosen not to do that action, then one wouldn’t have done it. Hume’s definition of a miracle as (1) an event caused by God’s will that (2) violates the laws of nature is yet another example from the early modern period. Gottlob Frege, Bertrand Russell, and G. E. Moore seemed to support the classical theory, and the view was taken more or less as a presumption in Twentieth-Century philosophy until the 1970s at least (Ludwig Wittgenstein 1958, being a notable exception). Contemporary defenders of the classical view include Jackson 1994, 1998, Pitt 1999, Peacocke 1992, and Earl 2002.

Objection (1): Plato’s problem. One perspicuous problem with the classical theory, according to its critics, is that few if any classical-style analyses have ever been widely agreed upon to be correct, especially for philosophically interesting concepts like [justice], [knowledge], and [free action]. This is termed Plato’s problem (by Laurence and Margolis 1999) since in many of Plato’s dialogues where Socrates searches for what we would call a conceptual analysis of some important concept (such as in the Lysis [friendship], Laches [courage], Euthyphro [piety], and Theatetus [knowledge]), the inquiry in the dialogue fails (or, more precisely, is presented as failing). One would think, however, that if the classical theory were correct, then at least some philosophically interesting concepts would have been analyzed successfully by now. Yet they have not, and there are hardly any widely agreed-upon classical analyses either, except perhaps in logic and mathematics. Such evidence might suggest that the classical theory is false, especially if other competing theories of concepts generate correct and widely agreed-upon analyses for concepts.

Objection (2): Problems involving typicality effects. Another problem for the classical theory involves a large body of empirical evidence concerning how humans sort objects into various categories. There is substantial evidence (summarized in Smith and Medin 1981, Rey 1983, Laurence and Margolis 1999, Murphy 2002, and Prinz 2002) that agents sort objects differently (in terms of speed of sorting, reliability of sorting, etc.) depending on how typical those objects are by way of being typical instances of the category in question. For instance, robins are sorted more quickly into the bird category than eagles, penguins, or ostriches, and some birds (e.g., ostriches and penguins) are more likely to be categorized incorrectly as not being in the bird category.

Such so-called typicality effects are the basis for a critical worry about the classical theory. For one might think that typicality effects suggest that what agents actually employ in acts of categorization are not lists of necessary and jointly sufficient defining conditions, but something else (perhaps lists of typical, but not defining features, as suggested by prototype theories of concepts, or perhaps some representation of a paradigmatic or most exemplary instance of that concept, as claimed by exemplar theories of concepts). But if what agents use in acts of categorization are not lists of defining features, this seems not in keeping with the classical theory. At the very least, if some other general theory of concepts accounts for typicality effects while at the same time addresses as many of the overall tasks for a theory of concepts to meet, then it would seem that theory ought to be preferred over the classical view. For instance, adherents of prototype/exemplar views of concepts (to be discussed below) take the empirical evidence concerning typicality effects as strong evidence in favor of their view, since such views analyze complex concepts in terms of the typical features that the empirical evidence seems to identify.

Objection (3): A general worry stemming from Quine’s attack on the analytic/synthetic distinction. If Quine’s (1953, 1960) famous critique of the analytic/synthetic distinction is successful, then the result generates apparently insuperable difficulties for the classical theory. For if Quine is right, then either there is no meaningful distinction between analytic and synthetic propositions, or the distinction does no meaningful philosophical work. Yet according to standard versions of the classical theory of concepts, classical analyses are analytic propositions (though see Ackerman 1981, 1986, and 1992 for the opposing view). In fact analyses and partial analyses such as A square is a four-sided regular figure and bachelors are unmarried males are usually considered to be paradigmatic examples of analytic propositions. But if there are no identifiable analytic propositions as such, then there are no identifiable classical analyses as such. Thus, it would seem that the classical theory is bankrupt if Quine is correct, for there would be no robust distinction between the analyses and the non-analyses, and there should be such a distinction if the classical theory is correct.

b. Neoclassical Theories

Another theory of concepts to consider is the neoclassical view (for further discussion, see Laurence and Margolis 1999 and Earl 2002). Neoclassical views all share a thesis common to the classical theory:

(NC) For every complex concept [C], [C] has individually necessary conditions for something to fall into its extension.

Alternatively, all neoclassical views hold the thesis that complex concepts have neoclassical analyses, where those analyses include (at least) a specification of necessary conditions for something to fall into the extension of the concept being analyzed. Neoclassical views differ from each other, and from the classical view, in terms of what further thesis is held with respect to sufficient conditions for something to fall into the extension of a given complex concept. For instance, one sort of neoclassical view might hold (NC) but hold that there are no concepts that have at least one sufficient condition. Another might hold (NC) but hold that at least some concepts have at least one sufficient condition. Furthermore, neoclassical views differ from one another in terms of what sort of sufficient conditions they posit all, some, or no complex concepts to have. For sufficient conditions themselves seem to come in two types: (1) sufficient conditions that have the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions, and (2) sufficient conditions that do not have such form. So there is a wide range of possible neoclassical views, corresponding to whether one holds that all complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition, or that some complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition, or that no complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition. And among these options, the views divide again with respect to what may be held with respect to what sort of sufficient conditions complex concepts have, or may have, or that some have, etc.

But despite this variety of neoclassical views, for expository and critical purposes only two neoclassical views need to be examined closely, and they can be stated as follows:

(NCV1) All complex concepts have individually necessary conditions, but at least one complex concept has no sufficient conditions of either sort.

(NCV2) All complex concepts have individually necessary conditions, but at least one complex concept has only at least one sufficient condition that does not have the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions.

The reason for examining only (NCV1) and (NCV2) is that eliminating them as possible views of concepts should suffice to eliminate all other varieties of neoclassical views, since other neoclassical views would seem to include either (NCV1), (NCV2), or both.

An objection: The problem of reference determination (and see also Laurence and Margolis 1999, 54-55; and Earl 2002, Ch. 5). One objection to consider is that neoclassical analyses fail to specify the extensions of concepts in a way that is adequate from the standpoint of accounting for concept individuation. That is, neoclassical views hold (at least) that some concepts have only neoclassical analyses (and not classical analyses) either in terms of only individually necessary conditions, or in terms of individually necessary conditions together with at least one sufficient condition not in the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions. The consequence is that distinct concepts could nevertheless share the same neoclassical analyses, and thus the neoclassical view is left with no adequate account of concept identity.

Consider the neoclassical views (NCV1) and (NCV2) once more. In order to evaluate these two views, one need only consider test cases for each view. Call those cases type 1 and type 2 cases:

Type 1: Concepts with individually necessary conditions, but with no sufficientconditions of either sort.

Type 2: Concepts with individually necessary conditions, and with no sufficient conditions that take the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions, but with at least one sufficient condition that does not take the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions.

Now take the cases in turn. Consider a test case of type 1, and (NCV1) claims that there are at least some concepts of this type. Let this concept be [C]. A neoclassical analysis of [C] solely in terms of necessary conditions will fail to specify the extension of [C] in an adequate way, it seems, for it would be possible for there to be another, distinct concept [D] with the very same neoclassical analysis. So holding that concepts only have analyses in terms of necessary conditions is insufficient for handling concept individuation.

The point is illustrated most perspicuously with two concepts known to be distinct, and yet share some necessary conditions. Take [parallelogram] and [rhombus], and suppose one offers the following neoclassical analyses for them:

A parallelogram is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and (3) with opposing sides parallel to each other.

A rhombus is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and (3) with opposing sides parallel to each other.

These two analyses specify the very same possible-worlds extension; i.e., they specify the very same reference for [parallelogram] and [rhombus]. But with such analyses only in terms of necessary conditions, neither concept’s extension has been adequately specified. For specifying [parallelogram] and [rhombus]’s extensions in this way leaves it open for them to be distinct concepts.

And they are distinct concepts, in this case, since not all parallelograms are rhombuses. So neither neoclassical analysis specifies the extensions of [parallelogram] and [rhombus] adequately, for while they entail that [parallelogram] and [rhombus]’s extensions overlap, they leave open the possibility that the extensions of [parallelogram] and [rhombus] do not coincide. But if their extensions do not coincide, this would entail that they are distinct concepts. So this sort of neoclassical analysis fails to provide an adequate account of reference determination, and thus (NCV1) fails.

Now consider a test case of type 2, and (NCV2) claims that there are at least some concepts of this type. Once more, neoclassical analyses along the lines of (NCV2) will be in terms of (i) some set of individually necessary conditions that are neither individually nor jointly sufficient; and (ii) some individually sufficient condition not having the form of a conjunction of necessary conditions. Such an account still fails to give an adequate account of reference determination.

For take [parallelogram] and [rhombus] again. Something’s being a square is sufficient for its being a parallelogram as well as for its being a rhombus. So include this sufficient condition in some neoclassical analyses for [parallelogram] and [rhombus]:

A parallelogram is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and a square is a parallelogram.

A rhombus is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and a square is a rhombus.

Such neoclassical analyses leave it open for [parallelogram] and [rhombus] to be distinct concepts, despite their having the same neoclassical analyses. For while squares are in the possible-worlds extension of [parallelogram], and also in the possible-worlds extension of [rhombus], the extension of [square] fails to match that of either [parallelogram] or [rhombus]. But [parallelogram] and [rhombus] share a common neoclassical analysis along the lines of (NCV2), and thus they would be identical if (NCV2) were correct, thus (NCV2) has failed to distinguish [parallelogram] from [rhombus]. The same predicament arises for any concepts sharing some necessary conditions and at least one sufficient condition. So (NCV2) fails, the critic might conclude.

The common problem claimed to exist with both sorts of neoclassical analysis is that such analyses fail to specify a complete possible-worlds extension for their analysanda (those concepts being analyzed), and the lesson here seems to be that analyses (of any sort) must do this if one is to distinguish concepts by means of their analyses. For an analysis solely in terms of necessary conditions (which are not jointly sufficient) specifies an extension larger than that of the analysandum (the concept doing the analyzing). But while adding a sufficient condition (not in terms of a conjunction of necessary conditions) to the analysis might capture all of the analysandum’s extension, it nevertheless might specify an extension smaller than the analysandum’s extension. And given that concepts not sharing the same possible-worlds extension are distinct, both neoclassical views’ take on analysis leaves the question of accounting for concept individuation unresolved.

c. Prototype/Exemplar Theories

Prototype theories of concepts come in two versions, and both claim to receive strong support from the existence of typicality effects for acts of categorization. One sort of prototype view holds that concepts should be analyzed in terms of a set of typical features of members of that concept’s extension. For a prototype view that analyzes a concept [C] in terms of lists of typical features, then for each typical feature there is merely some probability that x will have that feature given that x lies in the extension of [C]. So on this sort of prototype view (which is sometimes termed the probabilistic or the statistical view of concepts), the relationship between a concept and the concepts used to analyze it is a statistical relation, rather than an entailment relation (as in the classical theory).

The other sort of prototype view analyzes a concept in terms of a particular exemplary instance (or instances) of that concept, and for this reason is sometimes called the exemplar view of concepts. Whether or not some particular is in a given concept’s extension is then accounted for in terms of the degree of resemblance between that particular and the exemplar for that concept. The exemplar for [apple] might be colored a particular shade of red, have a particular rounded shape, have a particular taste, etc., and whether a particular greenish red thing counts as an apple depends on whether it sufficiently resembles the exemplar (or exemplars) for [apple]. (See Smith and Medin 1981, 1999; Fodor 1998; and Murphy 2002 for general discussion of the two prototype theories. Smith and Medin defend the view in their 1981.)

Objection (1): The problem of typicality effects for definitional concepts. A number of objections have been raised against prototype views, but three have been pressed most often by the critics. The first objection to consider is that there are some concepts that seem definitely not to follow the prototype view, yet are still such that typicality effects have been observed for them. A basic thesis of prototype theories seems to be that when typicality effects are present for a given concept, then the proper analysis for that concept will be in terms of lists of weighted features (on a probabilistic view) or in terms of exemplars (on an exemplar view). If it turns out that concepts that do not have prototypical analyses (e.g., if they have classical analyses) nevertheless are such that there are typicality effects for them, then this would be deeply problematic for prototype theories. Now, take [odd number], which is a concept that does indeed have a classical analysis. Armstrong, Gleitman, and Gleitman 1999 put the matter this way:

Are there definitional concepts? Of course. For example, consider the superordinate concept [odd number]. This seems to have a clear definition, a precise description; namely, an integer not divisible by two without remainder. No integer seems to sit on the fence, undecided as to whether it is quite even, or perhaps a bit odd…. But if so, then experimental paradigms that purport to show [bird] is prototypic in structure in virtue of the fact that responses to ‘ostrich’ and ‘robin’ are unequal should fail, on the same reasoning, to yield differential responses to ‘five’ and ‘seven’, as examples of [odd number] (234, notation for concepts adjusted).

So the idea is that if typicality effects for a concept [C] are intended by prototype theorists to show that [C] follows the prototype view, then for concepts that follow the definitional (or classical) view, there should not be any typicality effects for them.

But for [odd number], typicality effects have been observed for that concept: The number 3 has been found to be more “typical” of the odd numbers than 7, and 7 more “typical” than 501 and 447 (Armstrong, Gleitman, and Gleitman 1999, 232). But as far as the extension of [odd number] is concerned, no odd number is “more of” an odd number than any other, since all odd numbers are odd numbers to the same degree. But given the experimental evidence, the prototype view seems to predict that falling into the extension of [odd number] would be a matter of degree. But this prediction is false, and so it cannot be the case that the prototype view is correct for all concepts. What looks even more damaging is that the empirical results for [odd number] cuts the tie that prototype theorists hold to exist between empirical evidence concerning typicality effects and the proper analysis of concepts. That is, if typicality effects do not support a prototype analysis for [odd number], then it is doubtful that typicality effects support prototype analyses for [bird], [fruit], [sport], or any other concept.

Objection (2): The [pet fish] problem. Two other objections to be considered concern concepts with conjunctive logical form (like [pet fish]) and “negative concepts” (like [not a cat]). Fodor (1998, Ch. 5) has pressed the objection in a particularly clear way, and what follows here keeps closely to Fodor’s presentation. Both objections take as a basic premise the principle of compositionality, which can be stated as follows: “[T]he syntax and the content of a complex concept is normally determined by the syntax and the content of its constituents (Fodor 1998, 94).” That is, the content of an expression of a complex concept is normally determined by the logical constituents of that concept. For instance, in the sentence “Goldberg is a pet fish,” the predicate ‘is a pet fish’ expresses the concept of being a pet fish. The principle of compositionality then suggests that if one were to give an analysis of [pet fish], there should be an analysis of [pet fish] in terms of [pet] and [fish]. Similarly, in the sentence “Goldberg is not a cat,” ‘is not a cat’ expresses the concept of being not a cat, and there should be an analysis of [not a cat] in terms of [cat].

Aside from the intuitive appeal of the principle of compositionality, there are two compelling arguments in favor of it: One (paraphrased from Fodor 1998, 94-95) is that compositionality explains why our cognitive capacities are productive with respect to concepts. There are an infinite number of concept-expressing verbal expressions such that we can understand them, yet since the mind is finite the capacity for such understanding must be “finitely representable.” And since the principle of compositionality explains how such an infinite capacity can be had by a finite mind, one should accept the principle.

Another argument is that the principle of compositionality explains how our cognitive capacities are systematic with respect to concepts (and again see Fodor 1998, 97-99). One example should suffice to illustrate the explanatory tie between compositionality and systematicity: Provided that an agent can grasp what is meant by ‘John’ and ‘Mary’, and that she grasps what is expressed by the predicate ‘is loved by John and Mary’, then she can grasp what is expressed by ‘is loved by Mary and John’. The explanation for why the content of the latter expression can be grasped by an agent given that she grasps the content of the former expression is this. The content of both expressions is compositional, and is composed of the same logical constituents. Compositionality thus explains systematicity, and so the principle of compositionality should be accepted.

The so-called [pet fish] problem is this. For a complex concept like [pet fish] (which in this case has conjunctive logical form), its logical constituents include [pet] and [fish]. Given that the principle of compositionality holds, there should be an analysis of [pet fish] in terms of [pet] and [fish]. But consider the prototype theorist’s analysis of [pet], [fish], and [pet fish]. On a probabilistic view, each of these concepts would be analyzed in terms of lists of weighted typical features. But the list of weighted features for [pet fish] would not be the union of the lists of weighted features for [pet] and [fish]. For instance, the feature of being a dog might be weighted quite high in a prototypical analysis for [pet] (since dogs are typical pets), while being a dog would have to be weighted quite low (zero, in fact) in a prototypical analysis for [pet fish]. But these weights would have to be the same, it seems, if the principle of compositionality holds good. The problem is also perspicuous on an exemplar view’s analysis of [pet fish]: The exemplar for [pet] might be a dog, and the exemplar for [fish] might be a salmon. But if the exemplar for [pet fish] is a goldfish, it is hard to see how this kind of analysis for [pet fish] could ever be a decompositional analysis in terms of the exemplars for [pet fish]’s logical constituents. So prototype theories of concepts fail, the critic concludes. (See Fodor 1998, 102-103; Rey 1983, 260; 1985, 301-302; and Laurence and Margolis 1999, 37-43).

Objection (3): The problem of negative concepts. The third objection to prototype theories concerns what is expressed by negative predicates, such as the predicate of the sentence “Goldberg is not a cat.” It appears to be [not a cat], and according to the principle of compositionality this concept should have an analysis in terms of [cat]. But on a prototype view, [not a cat] seems not to have any prototype analysis at all, much less in terms of the prototypical analysis of [cat]. On a probabilistic view, the analysis of [not a cat] would be a list of weighted typical features of those things that are not cats. But it looks like there are no typical features shared by those things that are not cats. On an exemplar view, [not a cat] would be analyzed in terms of the prototypical thing (or type of thing) that is not a cat. But there is no such exemplar, it seems. So not only is it the case that “negative” concepts like [not a cat] have no prototype analyses in terms of their logical constituents, but they simply have no prototype analyses at all. And so prototype theories fail to account for an important class of concepts, and so the critics conclude that prototype theories fail.

d. Theory-theories

Two such views of concepts receive the name theory-theory, so-called due to the emphasis on general theories of a given category in accounting for various concepts of that category. One sort of theory-theory takes concepts to be structured representations analogous to theoretical terms in science, hence as constituents of propositions, and concepts are individuated in virtue of the roles they play in a “mental theory” an agent has with respect to some thing or category of thing. For instance, an agent might have a mental theory about dogs, and the concept she expresses by ‘is a dog’ in “Fido is a dog” is determined by the role(s) that concept plays in her overall theory of dogs. A mental theory in this sense is analogous to a scientific theory, represented in the mind, where such theories are sets of propositions (or representations of them) that are believed by an agent having that mental theory. Such a mental theory is also used to ground an agent’s inferences (such as explanations and predictions) with respect to what that theory happens to be about. The other sort of theory-theory identifies concepts with such internally represented theories themselves, and thus treats concepts as sets of represented propositions. There is obviously a tension here (as pointed out by Laurence and Margolis 1999, 44). One view treats concepts as being on the same ontological and semantic level (as has this article so far), namely as being entities in terms of which whole propositions are analyzed. Yet the other view treats concepts as being on the same ontological and semantic level as propositions (or sets of them). As this latter sort of theory-theory seems to require some means by which to individuate the various propositions that compose a mental theory, and this would require appeal to the very entities that have been called ‘concepts’ throughout this article, the sort of theory more in line with the other theories of concepts is the first sort of theory-theory. (Carey 1985, 1999 defends a version of the theory-theory, as do Murphy and Medin 1999.)

An objection: The problem of stability. The theory-theory’s view of concept individuation that emerges from its theory of meaning (which is holistic) seems to run contrary to the fairly obvious fact that different agents can possess the same concept. For let the content of a concept be determined by its inferential relations to other concepts as specified by a mental theory. Then two concepts [C] and [D] differ if there is any difference in [C] and [D]’s inferential relations to other concepts as specified by the respective mental theories that include [C] and [D]. But if theories determine the content of the concepts included in them, then any difference in theory seems to entail a difference in concept. Now the problem of stability arises: It is difficult to see how on the theory-theory agents holding different theories could ever possess the same concept. The problem also arises for the same individual if her own theory changes over time. In rejecting one theory in favor of another, the concepts “included” in that theory would change as well.

For instance, a person whose theory included the proposition (or a representation of the proposition) that arthritis was a disease of the muscles as well as the joints would presumably possess a different concept than a person who did not think arthritis was a disease of the muscles. For the first agent’s theory specifies an inferential relation between something’s being a case of arthritis and its being a disease of the muscles, while the other agent’s theory does not. So what the agents express by ‘arthritis’ fail to play the same roles in their respective mental theories, and so those two individuals do not possess the same concept: They express distinct concepts with their respective uses of ‘arthritis’.

This would be a minor problem except for the fact that such differences in mental theories would seem to be ubiquitous. If the theory-theory were right, then any difference in beliefs about arthritis entails a difference in mental theory, and thus there would be a difference between what such agents express by ‘arthritis’. Similarly, a child who believes that something looking like a dog but with no bones is nevertheless a dog would possess a distinct concept from a child who does not have such a belief. And in the general case, agents differ quite often in what they believe about members of a given category, and agents change their minds over time as to what they believe about members of a given category.

The difficulty is even worse if the theory-theorist adopts a global holism. For if one holds that all of one’s mental theories are interconnected by means of further inferential connections, then it seems that agents differing in any belief in any respect would thus possess none of the same concepts. This would clearly be counterintuitive, for surely at least some concepts are shared among different agents irrespective of the difference in the totality of their beliefs.

e. Atomistic Theories

The last theory of concepts to consider is conceptual atomism, or what Fodor (1998) calls informational atomism. Atomism differs from the classical, neoclassical, and prototype views in that while those views take concepts to have logical constitutions, atomism denies this. According to atomism, all or most concepts are such that they have no proper analyses in terms of any kind of “constituent” structure construed as a set of either proper-part containment, entailment, or statistical relations, and thus atomism takes all or most concepts to be primitive. Call strong atomism the thesis that all concepts are primitive in this sense, and moderate atomism the thesis that most concepts are primitive, but at least some concepts are complex.

Objection (1): The problem of radical nativism. The objection is an argument for the following claim: If atomism is right, then so-called radical nativism about concepts is true. Depending on what sort of atomism is at issue, then all or nearly all concepts turn out to be innate. Since this is counterintuitive, the critics conclude that there is good reason to reject conceptual atomism.

One note: What is meant by ‘innate’ in this context could mean a number of different things. A concept might be innate if it is “part of one’s nature,” or “hard-wired” into one’s mind from the start. The notion is reminiscent of Descartes’ position that some ideas are innate, such as the idea of God, of infinity, etc. This would indeed make for a counterintuitive result if most or all concepts turned out to be innate in this sense. Intuitively, the possession of [doorknob] (Fodor’s example) is not part of my nature, and nor is it a concept that I have always possessed. Alternatively, a concept might be innate if one has an innate capacity to grasp that particular concept (perhaps given the proper stimuli). It would be counterintuitive if most or all concepts turned out to be innate in this sense as well—[doorknob] seems not to be innate in this sense either. A still more general sense of ‘innate’ seems most adequate here. Take ‘innate’ to mean roughly the same thing as ‘unlearned’ and “unlearned” concepts are those concepts not acquired on any of the models of concept acquisition to be discussed below. And this more general sense of ‘innate’ is consistent with either of the two senses mentioned above: Such a concept could either always be grasped (in the sense of being part of one’s nature) or it could be graspable via some innate faculty tailored for that concept. (See also Fodor 1981 on different senses of ‘innate’ with respect to both innate ideas/concepts and innate cognitive capacities.)

The argument that atomism implies radical nativism runs as follows (from Fodor 1998, Ch. 6). According to conceptual atomism, all (or nearly all, or most) concepts are primitive, in the sense given in section 2b above. That is, atomism holds that all (or nearly all, or most) concepts have no analyses in terms of other, more basic concepts. But primitive concepts are unlearned, or innate, and so conceptual atomism is committed to the thesis that all (or nearly all, or most) concepts are innate. The conclusion is counterintuitive. What of the support for the premise that primitive concepts are innate? Why think that primitive concepts have to be unlearned?

There are two lines of thought to consider, the first given by Fodor (1998, 123-124). Acquiring or learning a concept (or the process of grasping a concept for the first time) is an inductive process, one might think. In acquiring a complex concept, one does so by testing various hypotheses about what properties are shared by all things in the extension of that concept. Succeeding in this process, or arriving at the right hypothesis about what properties are shared by all things falling under a concept, means that one has acquired that concept. However, not all concepts can be acquired in this way, and the concepts not acquired by the inductive model of concept acquisition are the primitive concepts. But we still possess or grasp such primitive concepts even if they are not learned, and so the stock of primitive concepts (however large this stock of primitives is taken to be) are all innate.

The general point seems to be this. If concept acquisition requires some process of hypothesis testing, then acquiring a new concept requires that some concepts already be possessed. For a hypothesis is a proposition, and grasping a proposition indeed seems to require at least some grasp of the concepts expressed in an expression of that proposition. So if hypotheses are tested in acquiring new concepts, and this is the only way to acquire or learn new concepts, then at least some concepts have to be unlearned. So some concepts have to be innate. Since atomists claim that most or all concepts are primitive, the stock of primitives is of course quite large, and thus radical nativism seems to follow.

Laurence and Margolis (1999, 62-63) consider a somewhat different argument for the same conclusion: Complex concepts are initially grasped by “assembling” them from their constituents, and such constituent concepts would have to already be grasped in order for such an assembly procedure to take place. For instance, suppose I grasp [bachelor] for the first time. On the “assembly” model, this occurs in virtue of combining tokens of [unmarried] and [male] by some capacity of conceptual combination, and I could not acquire [bachelor] in this way unless I already had some grasp of [unmarried] and [male]. Yet this sort of process cannot proceed unless there are some concepts not initially grasped by “assembling” them from their constituents. For instance, I might have acquired [male] in virtue of its being assembled from its constituents, and whatever [male]’s constituents are, I acquired them in virtue of their being assembled from their constituents. But this process had to begin with some concepts not initially acquired by this sort of assembly procedure. And these concepts will be the stock of primitives, since primitive concepts have no constituents to “assemble” them from. So if this model of acquiring complex concepts is right, and it is the only way in which concepts in general can be learned, then the consequence seems to be that primitive concepts are innate.

Objection (2): The problem of individuating coextensive and empty concepts. Another objection to atomism claims that since concepts have no structure (according to atomism, that is), atomists seem committed to a view of concept identity that distinguishes concepts from one another solely by their extensions (or possible-worlds extensions). This seems to entail that according to atomism, concepts with the same extension will be identical. But then the concepts [closed triangular figure] and [closed trilateral figure] would be identical, since they share the same possible-worlds extension. Furthermore, according to such an extensionalist view of concept identity, all concepts with no possible-worlds extension at all would be identical, such as [round square] and [round triangle]. However, [triangular closed plane figure] and [trilateral closed plane figure] seem distinct, since being three-angled is distinct from being three-sided, and so do [round square] and [round triangle]. The concepts [water] and [H2O] look to be distinct as well, since “This is a sample of water” and “This is a sample of H2O” seem to have distinct meanings. So the objection is that atomism is committed to a view of concept identity that is incorrect, and so atomism is false. (For Fodor’s replies see his 1998).

4. Conclusion

Research into the nature of concepts is ongoing, in both philosophy and psychology, and there is no general consensus in either field as to the preferred theory of concepts. The theories above primarily address the tasks of answering questions about the analysis of concepts, along with the broadly epistemic questions about them listed at the outset, while not always addressing the metaphysical questions directly. Yet the metaphysical issues do bear on the plausibility of one theory over another. As mentioned earlier, if concepts are abstract Platonistic entities, and not internal mental representations that are “in the head,” then the classical view might escape some of the objections raised by prototype theorists. Alternatively, if concepts are “in the head” as mental representations of some sort, and are structured in terms of the conditions one uses in sorting things as falling under that concept or not, then the classical theory looks bankrupt and the prototype theory looks superior to the rest. Whether the nature of a concept is to have such structure, as opposed to classical structure, a structure more along the lines of the theory-theory, some other structure entirely, or no structure at all, is a thoroughly unresolved matter.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Ackerman, D. F. 1981. “The Informativeness of Philosophical Analysis.” In P. French, et al. (Eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy, vol. 6. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 313-320.
    • Ackerman’s articles address the question of the nature of classical analysis, referencing G. E. Moore’s early work on the subject, and also C. H. Langford’s criticisms of Moore.
  • Ackerman, D. F. 1986. “Essential Properties and Philosophical Analysis.” In P. French, et al. (Eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy, vol. 11. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 304-313.
  • Ackerman, D. F. 1992. “Analysis and Its Paradoxes.” In E. Ullman-Margalit (Ed.), The Scientific Enterprise: The Israel Colloquium Studies in History, Philosophy, and Sociology of Science, vol. 4. Norwell, Massachusetts: Kluwer.
  • Armstrong, S. L., Gleitman, L. R., and Gleitman, H. 1999. “What Some Concepts Might Not Be.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 225-259.
    • Reports on typicality effects occurring for concepts with classical analyses, such as [odd number], and argues that the prototype theory is thus flawed.
  • Bealer, G. 1982. Quality and Concept. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Bealer, G. 1993. “Universals.” Journal of Philosophy 90 (1), 5-32.
    • A defense of a Platonistic view of universals.
  • Bealer, G. 1998. “A Theory of Concepts and Concept Possession.” Philosophical Issues 9, 241-301.
  • Carey, Susan. 1985. Conceptual Change in Childhood. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
    • An example of a view of concepts falling under the theory-theory.
  • Carey, Susan. 1999. “Knowledge Acquisition: Enrichment or Conceptual Change.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 459-487.
  • Chisholm, Roderick. 1996. A Realistic Theory of Categories: An Essay on Ontology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • A defense of Platonism about universals.
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    • As the title suggests, a defense of the classical theory.
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    • A seminal work by Fodor defending the view that thought has linguistic structure. Also includes discussion of innateness, both for concepts and for cognitive capacities.
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    • Distinguishes different senses of innateness, and considers different arguments and issues concerning the issue of innateness.
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    • An influential article defending the thesis that most concepts have no classical-style definitions.
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    • On G. E. Moore on classical conceptual analysis.
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    • Contains criticism of classical-style analyses.
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    • A defense of classical conceptual analysis.
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    • An introduction to the issue of the nature of concepts, with extensive discussion of the available views on concepts, with consideration of both support and criticism of each. The article is the introduction to Margolis and Laurence 1999.
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    • An anthology of historical and contemporary articles on concepts, by both philosophers and psychologists, with an expansive and useful introduction by the editors.
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    • A review of Peacocke 1992.
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  • Moore, G. E. 1966. Lectures on Philosophy. Ed. C. Lewy. London: Humanities Press.
    • Section I, entitled “What is Analysis?” concerns the nature of classical conceptual analysis.
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    • Includes more on Moore’s account of classical analysis.
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    • A monograph on theories of concepts, by one of the more important contemporary psychologists in the field.
  • Murphy, Gregory and Medin, Douglas. 1999. “The Role of Theories in Conceptual Coherence.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 425-458.
    • Considers various issues concerning the theory-theory of concepts.
  • Peacocke, Christopher. 1989a. “Possession Conditions: A Focal Point for Theories of Concepts.” Mind and Language 4 (1, 2), 51-56.
  • Peacocke, Christopher. 1989b. “What Are Concepts?” In Peter French, Theodore Uehling, and Howard Wettstein, (Eds.), Contemporary Perspectives in the Philosophy of Language II. Midwest Studies in Philosophy, Vol. XIV (Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press), 1-28.
  • Peacocke, Christopher. 1991. “The Metaphysics of Concepts.” Mind C (4), 525-546.
  • Peacocke, Christopher. 1992. A Study of Concepts. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
    • Peacocke’s primary and most detailed work on concepts, with the focus on possession conditions for concepts as the basic issue by way of understanding the nature of concepts.
  • Peacocke, Christopher. 2000. “Theories of Concepts: A Wider Task.” European Journal of Philosophy 8 (3), 298-321.
  • Pitt, David. 1999. “In Defense of Definitions.” Philosophical Psychology 12 (2), 139-156.
    • A defense of a classical-style view of concepts.
  • Plato. 1961a. The Collected Dialogues of Plato. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton, New Jersey: Princeton University Press.
  • Plato. 1961b. Euthyphro. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 169-185.
    • An early dialogue where the focus is on analyzing [piety].
  • Plato. 1961c. Laches. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 123-144.
    • A dialogue where the participants attempt to analyze [courage].
  • Plato. 1961d. Lysis. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 145-168.
    • A dialogue considering various analyses of [friendship].
  • Plato. 1961e. Theatetus. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 845-919.
    • A dialogue on the proper analysis of [knowledge], defending the traditional analysis of knowledge as justified true belief.
  • Prinz, Jesse J. 2002. Furnishing the Mind: Concepts and Their Perceptual Basis. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
  • Putnam, Hilary. 1966. “The Analytic and the Synthetic.” In H. Feigl and G. Maxwell, eds., Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. III. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 358-397.
    • An influential article attempting to undermine, among other things, the analytic/synthetic distinction, and with it the classical view’s commitment to analyses as analytic truths.
  • Putnam, Hilary. 1983. “‘Two Dogmas’ Revisited.” In Hilary Putnam, Realism and Reason: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 87-97.
  • Quine, W. V. O. 1953/1999. “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 153-170.
  • Quine, W. V. O. 1960. Word and Object. Cambridge: The M.I.T. Press.
  • Ramsey, William. 1992. “Prototypes and Conceptual Analysis.” Topoi 11, 59-70.
    • A defense of the prototype view, by way of criticizing the classical theory.
  • Rey, Georges. 1983. “Concepts and Stereotypes.” Cognition 15, 237-262.
    • A criticism of Smith and Medin 1981’s defense of the prototype theory, with exposition on general tasks for theories of concepts to accomplish.
  • Rey, Georges. 1985. “Concepts and Conceptions: A Reply to Smith, Medin and Rips.” Cognition 19, 297-303.
    • Further criticism of the prototype theory.
  • Rey, Georges. 1995. “Concepts.” In Samuel Guttenplan, (Ed.), A Companion to the Philosophy of Mind (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers), 185-193.
    • An encyclopedia entry on concepts.
  • Rosch, Eleanor. 1999. “Principles of Categorization.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 189-206.
    • An exposition of Rosch’s famous work from the 1970s illuminating typicality effects for various concepts.
  • Schlipp, P. (Ed.). 1968. The Philosophy of G. E. Moore. LaSalle, Illinois: Open Court.
  • Sibley, Frank. 1966. “Aesthetic Concepts.” In Cyril Barrett, Ed., Collected Papers on Aesthetics. New York: Barnes and Noble, 61-89.
    • This and the following reference defend a view of aesthetic concepts committed to a neoclassical treatment of them.
  • Sibley, Frank. 1973. “Is Art an Open Concept? An Unsettled Question.” In Matthew Lipman (Ed.), Contemporary Aesthetics (Boston: Allyn and Bacon, Inc.), 114-117.
  • Smith, Edward E. 1989. “Three Distinctions About Concepts and Categorization.” Mind and Language 4 (1, 2), 57-61.
  • Smith, Edward, E. and Medin, Douglas L. 1981. Categories and Concepts. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
    • Contains general discussion of research on theories of concepts up to 1981, with a defense of the prototype theory.
  • Smith, Edward, E. 1999. “The Exemplar View.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 207-221.
    • Chapter 7 of Smith and Medin 1981.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1958. Philosophical Investigations. 3rd Ed. New York: MacMillan.
    • Sections 65-78 include Wittgenstein’s critique of classical-style definitions.

Author Information

Dennis Earl
Email: dearl@coastal.edu
Coastal Carolina University
U. S. A.

Karl Popper: Critical Rationalism

popper“Critical Rationalism” is the name Karl Popper (1902-1994) gave to a modest and self-critical rationalism. He contrasted this view with “uncritical or comprehensive rationalism,” the received justificationist view that only what can be proved by reason and/or experience should be accepted. Popper argued that comprehensive rationalism cannot explain how proof is possible and that it leads to inconsistencies. Critical rationalism today is the project of extending Popper’s approach to all areas of thought and action. In each field the central task of critical rationalism is to replace allegedly justificatory methods with critical ones.

Section 2 explains how critical rationalism arose out of the breakdown of Popper’s first justificationist attempt to account for scientific progress. Section 2 also presents Popper’s first application of his non-justificationist perspective to new fields in his The Open Society and Its Enemies. Section 3 first explains Joseph Agassi’s view of the critical appraisal of metaphysical theories in scientific contexts as well as his view of piecemeal rationality, and secondly portrays William Bartley’s more comprehensive view of non-justificationism. Section 4 discusses Imré Lakatos’s extension of critical rationalism to mathematics. Section 5 portrays Hans Albert’s systematic version of critical rationalism. His perspective incorporated results of Popper, Agassi and Bartley and extended them to social and political theory. Section 6 suggests that Mario Bunge’s fallibilism ─ which he developed independently of critical rationalists ─ is sufficiently close to their views to count here: he develops critical tools for achieving progress without justification in virtually all areas of thought. Section 7 discusses attempts to develop critical rationalism in new and simpler ways. These views seek to do without frameworks and methodological rules; their originators are Jagdish Hattiangadi, Gunnar Andersson, and David Miller. These theories deprive rational thought of needed steering mechanisms. Section 8 presents the reintroduction of forms of justification designed to be compatible with Popper’s criticism of induction. These have been developed by Alan Musgrave, Volker Gadenne and John Watkins. Section 9 explains how Popper’s emphasis on the importance of methodological rules in science has led to a critical rationalist sociology of science. The main task of this sociology of science is to examine existing rules and methods as furthering or hindering research. Section 10 calls attention to the alternative philosophical anthropology which Agassi has proposed as a framework for critical rationalism. Whereas Popper saw rationality as contrary to human nature’s craving for security, Agassi sees rationality as natural, but partial and improvable. Section 11 describes how Popper’s original political manifesto in The Open Society and Its Enemies has led to attempts to use his arguments to defend both right-leaning and left-leaning political theories. Section 12 returns to Popper’s early researches in educational theory. His philosophy led to concerted efforts to develop a new pedagogy which emphasizes active problem solving as the best learning method. This pedagogy should promote autonomy and critical thinking. Section 13 concludes with the suggestion that the success or the failure of the project of substituting critical for allegedly justificatory methods has still to be judged.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Popper and Non-Justificationism
  3. Joseph Agassi and William Bartley
  4. Critical Rationalism in Mathematics
  5. Hans Albert
  6. Mario Bunge and Fallibilism
  7. Critical Rationalism without Frameworks of Methodological Rules
  8. Critical Rationalism, Truth and Best Theories
  9. Critical Rationalist Sociology of Science
  10. Philosophical Anthropology and Critical Rationality
  11. Critical Rationalism and Political Society
  12. Popper and Education Theory
  13. Conclusion
  14. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Critical rationalism emerged from research by the Würzburg school of psychology. This school sought to develop a deductivist philosophy of science to complement their deductivist psychology. While working on this program, Karl Popper stumbled onto a non-justificationist theory of scientific knowledge: he explained the growth of knowledge without proof. Non-justificationism, that is, the theory that no theory can be proven, is at least as old as Socrates, but Popper’s version of it is the first that also purports to explain the growth of knowledge. Popper and other critical rationalists took on the project of explaining the growth of knowledge without justification. This project has produced various competing theories of rationality and has been extended to many fields. This article will concentrate on the internal logic and problems involved in the development of critical methods capable of producing the growth of knowledge.

Of the numerous justificationist predecessors let only this be said. The overwhelming majority of those who comment on critical rationalism claim that critical rationalism is somehow incoherent and that inductivism is better. A major exception was Bertrand Russell. He appreciated the logical strength of critical rationalism and knew the logical weakness of induction. Nevertheless he clung to induction. He thought that critical rationalism was a philosophy of despair. Whether his judgment of critical rationalism was correct depends on whether its development can bring progress. To show this progress, new critical rationalist ideas are described and presented below. This should provide an answer to Russell that he amply deserves.

2. Popper and Non-Justificationism

Inductive inferences have observations as premises and theories as conclusions. They are notoriously invalid but often are deemed unavoidable. Critical rationalism views them as unnecessary. This point of view grew gradually out of Karl Popper’s attempt to describe science without their use in Die beiden Grundprobleme der Erkenntnistheorie (1932-33), where he still operated within the framework of justificationism, that is, while viewing the aim of scientific method as the proper (justified) assessment of the truth value of certain sentences. He hoped to build a theory of the proper assessment of sentences, that is, of the possibility of proving the truth or falsity of some sentences. He began with the fact that a theory is false if it contradicts a singular sentence describing some observation reports. Popper then said that such singular sentences were veridical, that is, truthful as opposed to illusory, so they may be used to produce final proofs of the falsity of some universal sentences. For example, the singular sentence, “That swan is black,” if it is a true report of some observation, can be used to produce a final proof of the falsity of the universal sentence, “All swans are white.” But, he argued, proof of universal sentences or the demonstration that they are probable requires inductive inferences. As a consequence no such putative proof can be valid.

Popper himself found the theory he presented in Die beiden Grundprobleme der Erkenntnistheorie without chapter 5 inadequate for three reasons. The first reason is that singular statements are not veridical. He began work on this problem in chapter 5 of Die beiden Grundprobleme. This chapter contains a theory of science which differs on important points from the theory found in the rest of that volume. The second reason that Popper’s first attempt broke down is that one can circumvent refutations by ad hoc stratagems, as Hans Reichenbach quickly pointed out in a note which responded to Popper’s first publication of his view in Erkenntnis. The third reason was Popper’s inability to handle the problem of the demarcation of science from non-science with his idea that we show how science properly assigns truth values to sentences with no inductive inference. On a justificationist theory of the task of the philosophy of science such as Reichenbach’s, which was identical to Popper’s theory as he wrote Die beiden Grundprobleme without chapter 5, science should be demarcated by the proper assignment of truth values: science is the set of sentences with justifiably assigned truth values. The task of the philosophy of science is to explain how these assignments are properly made. (Reichenbach said the calculus of probabilities serves that purpose.) Popper argued that it is not possible to properly assign either the truth value True or some degree of probability to universal sentences. He called such sentences “fictions”, which is a term he had earlier taken over from Hans Vaihinger. On the theory presented in Die beiden Grundprobleme without chapter 5, after science had done its job, there were still, on the one hand, some fictions which ought to be deemed scientific such as the theories of the Würzburg school in psychology and, perhaps, as he said later, Einstein’s physics, and, on the other hand, other fictions which should be deemed unscientific, such as the psychologies of Freud and Adler. He could not distinguish between these two sets of theories within his justificationist framework, since, on this view, only proofs or refutations of these theories could do that. He asserted, however, that no proof was possible and refutations could establish only the falsity of universal propositions.

As a consequence of these three difficulties Popper developed an entirely different theory of science in chapter 5, then in Logik der Forschung. In order to overcome the problems his first view faced, he adopted two central strategies. First, he reformulated the task of the philosophy of science. Rather than presenting scientific method as a tool for properly assigning truth values to sentences, he presented rules of scientific method as conducive to the growth of knowledge. Apparently he still held that only proven or refuted sentences could take truth values. But this view is incompatible with his new philosophy of science as it appears in his Logik der Forschung: there he had to presume that some non-refuted theories took truth values, that is, that they are true or false as the case may be, even though they have been neither proved nor refuted. It is the job of scientists to discover their falsity when they can. So, he worked around the difficulty posed by the fact that, on the one hand, he had to assume that theories were refutable and thus had truth values, whereas, on the other hand, he thought that only proven or refuted theories had truth values at all. He argued that his view could be interpreted as realist or as antirealist. He hedged his bets as best he could and appealed to Mach, who had stipulated that one should avoid participation in any metaphysical dispute.

In Logik der Forschung Popper solved his three initial difficulties in the following ways. First, instead of claiming that singular sentences were veridical, he said that basic statements are only provisionally accepted, provided that they were repeatable and so testable. He thereby introduced the following rule: consider only repeatable basic statements. He claimed that the provisional acceptance of basic statements does not disqualify them as refutations of theories—no longer simply universal sentences—because for the most part we can agree on which basic sentences we provisionally assume to be true. Second, he proposed the rule that one should always replace some theory which is contradicted by a basic statement by whichever new alternative has the highest degree of falsifiability. This rule should guarantee that refutations lead to progress. Reichenbach had declared that there was no logic of scientific method, that is, no proof or refutation. The basis for his claim that there could be no refutation was that any theory could be protected from a putative refutation with some ad hoc maneuver. Popper responded to Reichenbach with his Logik der Forschung (Logic of Research) and by introducing methodology into his deliberations. The methodological rule enabled him to avoid ad hoc protection of theories and thus enabled him to show how theories could be refuted. Third, he introduced the rule: only refutable theories—the term “fiction” no longer appears in his work—are scientific and may be deemed scientific.

This view was no longer justificationist, that is, it no longer claimed properly to assign truth values to sentences. All “assignments” are conjectural. But Popper had at that point no non-justificationist theory of rationality in general; his theory applied to science alone. He did not at that point notice problems which his theory raised for the broader framework of rationality which all philosophers of science had used since antiquity, the framework that identified the rational with the proven.

The conflict between Popper’s new theory of science and his older theory that only proven or refuted sentences can take truth values was removed by Tarski. Tarski’s definition of truth, as Tarski explained to Popper, allows for non-proven but still true sentences. Tarski thereby did away with the theory of truth that had given Popper so much trouble. Tarski did not necessarily offer Popper an adequate theory of truth for his philosophy of science. But Tarski did free him from a false theory which was a great impediment to the construction of a truly fallibilist, realist theory of science. Popper never clearly explained the importance that Tarski had for him at the time. This failure to explain how the logic of his problem changed as a result of Tarski’s theory was part of his repression of the fact that he had held a justificationist theory of truth for a long time, even after he began writing a fallibilist book. After his meeting with Tarski, he was free to develop his fallibilist theory of science in new ways, because he could claim that theories could be true even though there was no proof of them. During his earlier years in London, during 1946-1965 or so, he returned to the possibilities this fact opened up.

In Logik der Forschung Popper developed a theory of the growth of scientific knowledge without justification. But he had no general theory of rationality without justification. Indeed, he still limited rationality to science and methodology. However, at least three problems arose for this limited view of rationality.

Popper maintained at that point that scientists gain knowledge not by proofs but by refutations of good conjectures and by replacing them with new and better ones. These new conjectures avoid earlier mistakes, explain more, and invite new tests. He originally thought of this theory as eo ipso a theory of rationality: outside of science and methodology he made no allowance for rationality. He identified research, science and methodology, as the title of his book indicates.

Difficulties piled up fast. First, if rationality is limited to science, how is methodology rational? Methodology can only be rational if methodology is the empirical study of science—as Whewell said—or if non-empirical research can be rational. Popper could not view methodology as a science of science because he held that it is not merely descriptive but also prescriptive. Yet it should be rational.

The second problem arose as Popper tried to apply his methodology of the physical sciences to the social sciences. The Poverty of Historicism and The Open Society and Its Enemies defend the open society on the grounds that only open societies preserve reason, that is, criticism, and as a consequence only open societies can be civilized. But why is a choice for the open society rational? He had no answer. He merely said that the acceptance of reason was a consequence of sympathy for others. Nothing can be said to convince those to change their minds who accept the barbaric consequences of fascism or communism.

The third problem concerns metaphysics. Before he had ever developed his own philosophy of science, he had defended in his doctoral dissertation the view that metaphysical hypotheses can serve as working hypotheses in the construction of scientific theories. His discussion there merely concerned the use of physicalist metaphysics as a guide for psychological research. He said that this was fine, but one should not decide a priori that a view of psychological processes as physical is needed or even possible. Scientific research—he was not clear then what that meant—should decide this. He was later pressed, however, to decide between competing metaphysical theories with which to interpret science, even in the absence of a scientific answer. Was the world determined or not? Questions such as this raised the question as to whether one metaphysical theory can be better or worse than another and whether one could find out which one is better. He gave up his earlier view of rationality as limited to scientific research and methodology, but he still insisted that for science some metaphysical theories are merely heuristic, and no more than that.

To extend his theory that rationality consisted of scientific research and methodology alone, Popper loosened his standard of rationality. Rejecting the older standard of rationality — proof – – as too high, he began to view the standard for science, refutability, as too high for the rationality that obtains outside science. Whereas earlier he had replaced justification with refutation, he now replaced refutation with criticism. Popper thereby created a new philosophical perspective by generalizing his theory of scientific research. The name he gave to this extension is “critical rationalism.” Popper introduced it in the introduction to his Conjectures and Refutations, where he characterized it briefly as the critical attitude. He used it also to describe views he developed earlier, in The Open Society and Its Enemies.

Could his critical rationalism apply to other fields? Could various fields also not only do without (epistemological) justification but also raise their levels of rationality with the use of critical methods? Critical rationalism became a project to employ critical methods as a substitute for epistemological justification in all areas of life.

3. Joseph Agassi and William Bartley

Outside of Popper’s own efforts to develop this project, the first two most significant endeavors were undertaken by Joseph Agassi and William Bartley. Although Agassi’s efforts began somewhat earlier than Bartley’s, their development overlaps considerably; the two were in conversation with each other for much of the time that they were working out their ideas as Popper’s students. I begin with Agassi, who developed Popper’s philosophy piecemeal and then turn to Bartley who attempted to give critical rationalism a comprehensive statement, that is, a version of it which would explain how a critical rationalist could adopt a critical stance toward any idea whatsoever, including its own claims.

Agassi began with his dissertation, in which he posed the question, How can metaphysics be used to guide scientific research without making science subordinate to it? Duhem had warned that, were science to concern itself with metaphysics, it would be subordinate to it. Encouraging scientists to engage in metaphysical debates would cause dissent and lead them away from science’s main task of constructing empirical theories.

Agassi’s project was to show how metaphysical research could facilitate empirical progress without tyrannizing science. He did this by extending Popper’s theory of the methods of scientific practice to include the critical, and thereby progressive, use of metaphysical theories to guide scientific research. On his view metaphysics need not be a mere heuristic, that is, a source of ideas, but rather a systematic guide to scientific research and a provisional standard for desirable theories. Metaphysics can be useful in advancing science by giving guidelines for the search for empirical explanations and by deepening the understanding of the world offered by science. But, he also said, it can help achieve these aims only when used critically. A critical stance toward metaphysics is possible when two or more metaphysical research programs compete with each other to construct empirically refutable theories. This, he argued, is just what happened when Faraday used his metaphysical field theory as the framework within which he constructed physical (field) theories. His competitors tried to explain the same phenomena under the Newtonian assumption that all forces act at a distance. Faraday’s theory of electro-magnetic events eventually had an enormous impact, because his metaphysics enabled him to construct better physical theories than his competitors.

Bartley developed a comprehensive version of critical rationalism. He argued that there were two problems that showed Popper’s original version was too limited. Popper encountered the first of these as he wrote The Open Society and Its Enemies where he discussed the problem: Why should one be rational? He conceded that rationality is limited, as its choice is pre-rational, a decision based on feelings. Bartley viewed Popper’s problem of the limits of the ability to argue rationally in favor of rationality as parallel to a problem he (Bartley) had earlier encountered in religious philosophy: defenders of religion claim that commitment to some religion is just as rational as commitment to rationality: each individual has to choose some starting point, and each starting point must be arbitrary. Each starting point then is just as pre-rational as the other, since each choice is beyond the limits of reason.

Bartley viewed the inability to defend rationality rationally as amounting to the inability to show the superiority of rational methods to solve problems over any other method. Bartley saw this limitation as an important defect. But in Popper’s approach to rationality as critical rather than justificatory, he found a way to overcome it. For, he argued, on the one hand, the theory of rationality as proof should itself be proven, but in fact it is not provable, whereas, on the other hand, the theory of rationality as readiness to appraise theories critically should itself be open to criticism, and this is quite possible. It is then no longer the case that the adoption of a rational approach to problems is no more rational than commitments to belief systems, such as those of some religion: the theory that rational practice means holding all theories open to criticism, may itself be held open to criticism. This also means that the use of rational methods to solve problems may be rationally defended, that is, we may use rationality to answer objections to the use of rationality.

Could this theory allow one to hold religious beliefs rationally by holding them open to criticism? Bartley never answered this question explicitly. He hinted that he did believe this was the case, and some have understood him as adopting this position. Some critical rationalists are believers and some are not. Standards here remain vague. The winner of the Popper essay prize argued that Christians were also critical rationalists, because they discussed, for example, the theological significance of their religious experiences and have developed their views at Church councils. (Elliot 2004) Agassi has pointed out that the Talmudic tradition is highly critical within certain bounds, yet cannot be said to have a high degree of rationality. If all critical discussions, even those within sects, qualify their practitioners as critical rationalists, then critical rationalism itself dissolves. To take seriously the replacement of justification with criticism, Agassi suggests, requires demarcation between effective and ineffective critical methods.

Bartley called his view “comprehensively critical rationalism” to distinguish it from Popper’s critical rationalism. It should not merely explain how one can conduct rational inquires in specific fields, but it should apply to the theory of rationality itself. Bartley added a list of critical standards one may use to evaluate ideas in any area whatsoever: a proposed idea should be a solution to an important problem, internally consistent, not refuted, and consistent with science. The first three are incorporated into virtually all critical rationalist theories. The fourth has been treated with more caution: science might also be mistaken, especially when it contains competing theories. A new metaphysical alternative may be inconsistent with established physical theory, as Faraday’s was, yet be quite important for progress.

John Watkins considered Bartley’s theory a reinforced dogmatism with a “Heads I win, tails you lose” strategy: If comprehensive critical rationalism faces no effective criticism it wins, but if it does, it thereby shows that it can meet its own standards and then again it wins. This criticism overlooks the fact that, if it faces effective criticism, it is shown to be wrong. Bartley’s standard is a necessary condition of rationality, but meeting it is no reason for clinging to an effectively criticized theory.

Bartley’s ideal of holding all ideas open to criticism has been an important part of critical rationalism. But it soon became apparent that the problems of how to develop critical rationalism were more important than demonstrating just how comprehensive it could be or of maintaining this comprehensive position. In order to see how and why this realization came about it is useful to return to Agassi.

Agassi deems the focus of Bartley’s of approach to be misplaced: it unduly emphasizes the defense of rationality as rationally defensible. Rationality does not need defense; it needs improvement, Agassi says. And we may try to improve it piecemeal. We are all rational to some degree and are all interested from time to time in using reason more effectively than we now do. We cannot help but be rational, since thinking is, like seeing, innate to some extent. No one is always rational or perfectly rational any time. Our best hope, then, is to use rationality to improve the partial and limited rationality which we all use to one degree or another. We use a bootstrap process in that we use the rational methods we now have at hand to develop better methods, whereby the methods we use may very well be corrected or even discarded.

Agassi also applied Popper’s non-justificationism to the historiography of science. Like many, Popper wanted the theory of science to describe science, but he hardly tried to apply his view to the history of science. Agassi developed a far wider picture of the history of science from Popper’s viewpoint, contrasting the traditional inductivist and conventionalist historiographies with a non-justificationist one. Inductivism distorts the history of science as it is the view of innovations as either completely right or quite useless; conventionalism distorts the history of science because it explains away radical changes. John Wettersten extended this application to the historiography of psychology, explaining how a non-justificationist approach was needed to remove peculiar distortions there.

4. Critical Rationalism in Mathematics

In Proofs and Refutations Imré Lakatos extended the range of critical rationalism into mathematics. This area is just where one would expect that it would be the most difficult to develop a theory of the growth of knowledge by criticism rather than by proof, or, as Lakatos put it, by proofs and refutations. Putative counter-examples, he illustrated historically, often refute “proofs” and thus require improvements.

Lakatos did not provide for the use of frameworks to formulate problems in mathematics, nor did he discuss the rules which mathematicians should follow in formulating and criticizing proofs. He forcefully argued against premature formalization, but he did not allow for the modern method of introducing a field axiomatically from the start. His theory of response to criticism only shows that varying ways of responding to problematical cases are available.

As a beginning this is fine. But caring for the central task of critical rationalism, that is, for the development of critical methods (in mathematics) as an alternative to the quest for justifications, requires the replacement of justificationist methods with critical ones. Is this at all possible? Answers to this question might enlighten us about the rationality of mathematical research. They might supplement and/or improve Lakatos’s portrayal of mathematical research by accounts of the ways it proceeds, and explain how decisions about the direction of research are made rationally.

Several thinkers have taken up this question; but with only one exception, they have sought to use Lakatos’s justificationist methodology of scientific research programs. The exception is Peggy Marchi who broke off her research before she had constructed any developed view. Three thinkers, however, have made attempts to take Lakatos’ methodology of research programs in a critical spirit and then apply it to the history of mathematics.

D.D. Spalt (Spalt 1981) argues that Lakatos’ methodology of research programs is inapplicable to the history of mathematics as mathematicians are more open skeptical and critical than Lakatos’ methodology describes. This confirms Lakatos’s turn away from a critical approach, but does not help us further since it does not go on to ask if a genuinely critical approach, say, to the use of research programs such as Agassi’s would help us. But Spalt also finds no mathematicians who follow any clear research program at all. He defends a view of mathematics which has great similarity to Feyerabend’s view of science: there is no methodology which can describe all mathematical research.

G. Giorello (Giorello 1981) argues that Lakatos’ theory of scientific research programs is better applicable to mathematical research than Popper’s or Kuhn’s. Teun Koetsier in turn found Giorello’s argument inadequate (Koetsier 1991 pp. 145ff.). This is not surprising, since Lakatos’ methodology of research programs is sketchy.

Koetsier was not satisfied with Giorello’s vague results nor with Spalt’s negative ones. He proposed a revision of Lakatos’ theory which would enable him to describe how mathematical research proceeds. His revised version is closer to Agassi’s theory of research programs, which, Agassi suggested, might be used to explain how mathematical problems were chosen and how mathematical research was coordinated.

Lakatos’s historical reconstructions of mathematical developments are Popperian in that they portray not only mathematical theorems and their proofs, but also their refutations, and their replacement by new ones. Koetsier criticizes this portrayal. He finds instead that the aim of mathematical research has been directed at refining mathematical theorems. The refined theorems are then by and large accepted and entered into the body of mathematical knowledge, where they then stay, subject only to further refinements. Koetsier agrees, however, that Lakatos’s theory does show how mathematicians work when solving problems within some narrowly defined areas of research. This research is fallible, he agrees, and this allows it to progress by the discovery of difficulties with previous theories which are overcome by succeeding ones.

Koetsier discusses clusters of mathematical theories that are part of identifiable research traditions. These traditions pose their own problems and are identifiable by their offerings of clusters of mathematical theorems. Each tradition, however, is not replaced by some competing one as in the case of science, where one explanation is superseded by another leading to the rejection of the former. In this respect the theories of science of Popper and/or Lakatos cannot be applied to the history of mathematics. Rather, each theory progresses in its domain and the results it produces are largely cumulative.

In order to explain how progress is made in such research traditions, Koetsier employs the suggestion made by Marchi that theorems should be taken as analogous to facts. (Marchi 1976) Whereas scientists seek to explain facts, mathematicians seek to prove theorems. Theorems are, just as facts, accepted provisionally. Instead of seeking to explain them as in science, mathematicians seek to prove them. Mathematics grows as new theorems are discovered and proved.

This theory leads back to the problem posed by Agassi and Marchi: How is research coordinated? Koetsier finds that Lakatos’s theory of mathematics describes “local” mathematical research rather well. It describes how they solve problems within some cluster of theories and/or methods. He finds various research traditions, which have been used to set problems. But, he does not explain how such traditions arise nor why they are chosen. Mathematical research is, then, coordinated by interests in particular kinds of mathematical objects and/or particular methods. But, how are these chosen? Why do they change?

Koetsier also faces the question: Which theorems should mathematicians prove and why? He notes that some are central and others that seem simply too ad hoc to bother with. But, how does one decide? He offers a list of measures by which to judge the importance of theorems. His list of methods for appraising the ad hoc nature of theorems is interesting but still rather ad hoc. (Koetsier p. 170-171)

Agassi’s theory of metaphysical research programs might have helped him here. Unlike Lakatos’ inferior and subsequent theory, Agassi’s was designed to solve the problems of “How is scientific research coordinated?” or “How do scientists choose their problems?” and “How can we explain simultaneous discoveries?” His answer is that problems in science are often chosen for their relevance to metaphysical problems. He developed at some length and in some depth the conflict between Faraday’s field theory and Newton’s atomic theory to show how problems were chosen which bore on this controversy and how the two metaphysical research programs could compete against each other.

How much of the choice of problems in the history of mathematics can be explained by Agassi’s conjecture that they are regularly chosen due to their relevance to metaphysical problems? This is still an open question. But some problems clearly were. Among them are problems concerning irrational numbers, whether numbers exist in a Platonic world, problems concerning the nature of infinitesimals or irrational numbers or the square root of minus one or the nature of transfinite numbers as well as questions concerning the possibilities of non-Euclidean geometries. A history of mathematics written from this point of view might be enlightening, if it could portray underlying metaphysical concerns as focusing mathematical research on certain kinds of problems and the development of methods to deal with them.

It should be noted that J. O. Wisdom had portrayed the development of the calculus as a response to the criticisms of Berkeley before Lakatos began his research (Wisdom 1939; 1941). His view is less radical than Lakatos’s however, since Lakatos, but not Wisdom, said that the growth of mathematical knowledge by proofs and refutations continues even after the introduction of new formal methods of logic. The formal proofs in the logical language are indeed, Lakatos says, immune from refutations, but the translations from the mathematical into the logical language are always open to question.

5. Hans Albert

In the 1960s, Hans Albert began to apply critical rationalism to social and political theory. His writings have become the standard statement of critical rationalism in the German-speaking world, if not elsewhere. He argues that any attempt at justification faces a three-pronged difficulty that is traceable to Agrippa: One alternative leads to an infinite regress as one seeks to prove one assumption but then needs to assume some new one; a second alternative lands in a circular argument as one assumes what one seeks to prove; a third alternative takes some arbitrary starting point and holds to it dogmatically. Outside of these three unacceptable moves, justificationism offers no other alternative. Since none of these three alternatives provide any justification at all, we should abandon the quest for justification. Instead we should hold all theories open to criticism, as Popper and Bartley have proposed. He takes over Agassi’s theory of research programs, but, due to his emphasis on the comprehensive nature of critical rationalism, tends to side with Bartley more than Agassi on questions of rationality. He has never, however, had any open dispute with Popper, Bartley or Agassi even though the three thinkers disagree on various significant points. He builds what he can from their points of view into his own version and avoids controversial issues among critical rationalists, while developing polemics against its detractors.

His major project is to explain how the theory of rationality proposed by Popper, Bartley and Agassi is, or can be made to be, applicable to virtually all areas of human endeavor—ethics, politics, social science, science, and so forth. He has from time to time presented this as an alternative to the so-called Frankfurt School that was especially influential in Germany in the late 60s and 70s. Its members thought themselves capable of deep analyses of society to show what went wrong in German history—why, for example, Germany was authoritarian. Members of this school berated alternatives such as Albert’s as “positivist,” by which they seemed to have meant that it did not take into account the human dimensions of imperfect institutions. Because it looked at them too narrowly from an empirical, technical perspective it passed over too quickly the unhappy consequences they have. Albert countered that the failure to separate descriptive and prescriptive questions leads to the failure of the Frankfurt School to draw a realistic picture of society and such a picture is the necessary foundation for any adequate theory of social reform, which critical rationalism by no means opposes. It attempts rather to make it realistic. The political ideas of critical rationalism as presented by Popper and by Albert were the most popular in Germany next to those of the Frankfurt School. Albert also presented critical rationalism as superior to the hermeneutic theories of Hans-Otto Apel and Hans Georg Gadamer.

Albert has dealt extensively with methodology in economics, criticizing neo-classical economics for its unrealistic assumptions about the rationality of human actions, and its presumptions that there can be a measure of the social welfare of society. But he views the tradition of neoclassical economics as the best that the social sciences have to offer. He hopes to reform it by making its psychological assumptions more realistic. Here he decidedly parts company with Popper, who is far more skeptical about the use of theories of human nature, especially psychological ones. Albert rejects what he consider to be the exaggerated assumptions of rational-choice economics, and he suggests Popper’s methodological individualism is not the same as the one that economists often use. But he has not constructed any systematic alternative.

6. Mario Bunge and Fallibilism

The researches mentioned so far grew directly out of Popper’s non-justificationist theory of science. Mario Bunge developed a non-justificationist theory of science, especially of physics, before he had ever heard of Popper, and he does not view his work a part of the project known as critical rationalism. It nevertheless can count as a version of critical rationalism: it is a non-justificationist effort to improve standards of criticism. Bunge describes the crucial event in the later development of his philosophy as the realization that frameworks—he calls them systems–were crucial for the growth of knowledge. Bunge’s “systems” differ from the “frameworks,” whose usefulness is emphasized by some critical rationalists, if they differ at all, in taking as the best critical methods and most progressive research the formal, precise wording of theories. Bunge apparently feels more affinity with those thinkers who emphasize the use of formal methods and who futilely seek justification, than with those who deny the possibility of justification and deem the use of formal methods more limited than he does. This is understandable, since he holds that the attainment of precision is crucial for rationality and, on his view precision is best obtained with formal methods, and sometimes can be obtained only in this way. As a corollary of this attitude, he proposes to respond to difficulties first with small changes that preserve systems, and move to larger ones when these prove inadequate. This is the exact opposite of what Popper said, as he advocated that one should always prefer that theory which has the highest degree of falsifiability. These thinkers, however, do not disagree about the aim of the philosophy of science, which is to improve critical standards so that the best possible theories are created and honed, but rather about the best means for doing that. In the wake of Einstein, Agassi resolves this conflict by proposing that both approaches can be used simultaneously.

7. Critical Rationalism without Frameworks of Methodological Rules

In contrast to critical rationalists who emphasize the need for both theoretical frameworks and methodological rules, there are also critical rationalists who dispense with both. Jagdish Hattiangadi, Gunnar Andersson and David Miller are examples. Hattiangadi says that all problems are contradictions encountered in attempts to master everyday problems of survival. Theoretical frameworks play no role in the formulation of problems, though traditions apparently do. It is hard to see the difference. One of the difficulties that his view encounters is that it makes it impossible to define problems well. For, the problem posed by the assumptions {p, ~p, a, b, c} turns out to be the same as the problem posed by the assumptions {p, ~p, x, y, z}. Another difficulty the theory faces is that it should, but does not, present a contradiction to earlier versions of critical rationalism that it allegedly improves upon. Moreover, some problems are due to gaps in our knowledge that are not contradictions. Formulations of good problems thus require frameworks that include some selection rules.

Posing problems of knowledge in terms of the identification of methodological rules for gaining knowledge was the crucial breakthrough that enabled Popper to move beyond his early Die beiden Grundprobleme. When one dispenses with them, one has an ad hoc approach to critical methods. They grow of themselves, Hattiangadi suggests, as attempts to solve practical problems. No other special critical activity is needed or useful. He explains the growth of critical methods as part of the struggle for survival: those who use the best methods to solve practical problems survive and reproduce themselves best. This view runs the danger of relapsing into Hegelianism, since it judges as best any intellectual development which is successful. Should fundamentalist Hinduism or Islam or Christianity (or all of them together) win the day, will they then be the best expression of rationality?

Gunnar Andersson views Popper’s introduction of methodological rules as quite unnecessary: all contradictions between theories and observations pose problems and all responses to them should be prima facie acceptable. He takes off the table the most crucial aspect of the project of critical rationalism: how can we best improve our critical methods and our capacity to learn from mistakes? Even without any appeal to an evolutionary process such as that used by Hattiangadi, Andersson assumes that science will do just fine without critical studies of its methods. He does not discuss his optimism or the fears of those who do not share it. He says virtually nothing about non-scientific inquiry and rational action.

David Miller’s critical rationalism is the third example of attempts to characterize rationality without explaining how the use of theoretical frameworks or methodological rules furthers it or hinders it. He concentrates on improving criticism of the logic of justification; he ignores Popper’s crucial move from the mere portrayal of the logic of research to the formulation of methodological rules. He agrees that science is better off because it handles theories critically, but does not bother with the details. He ignores the question: How is the use that science makes of criticism distinct, if at all, from other uses of it? However, he apparently sides with Bartley’s comprehensively critical rationalism. He has effectively bolstered Popper’s arguments against attempts to use induction to establish any degree of probability of any theory and effectively criticized Popper’s theory of verisimilitude. Having concluded that there is no evidence which can increase the probability that a theory is true, he concludes that there can be no good reasons whatsoever for any theory or any course of action. All we can ask, he suggests, is: Why not? We only have reasons for the rejection of theories, never for their endorsement.

But it does not follow from his correct observation that we can have no evidence which increases the probability that a theory is true, that there are no good reasons to consider any theory true. Miller suggests that in the interest of truth we should not make fanciful claims. But he says nothing about reasons for preferring, say, highly explanatory theories over less explanatory ones, or ones that solve problems better than others, or that we can improve our methods of elimination of theories beyond the mere random quest for contradictions. On a commonsense understanding of good reasons, all these possibilities may constitute good reasons for preferring some theories over others, even if they do not increase the probability that any theory is true.

On Miller’s view it seems a person can declare true any unrefuted theory, say a minimal astrological theory, or Descartes’ theory that souls have no extension, without violating any rationalist precept. He does not offer any selection procedure. He relies entirely on the interest in the truth, which, he claims, prevents arbitrariness. This is hardly enough: arbitrariness is not obvious. He rejects the possibility of taking advantage of our ability to assign truth values as we fancy, as it is frivolous; he does not tell us how to spot the frivolous. Talmudists and scholastics certainly have an interest in truth, are hardly frivolous, and use arguments extensively, yet they are hardly rational in any way comparable to the rationality of scientists. Popper’s mature philosophy began as he specified rules that should prevent frivolity. He saw the need for methodological rules to make criticism effective.

Some critics say Miller’s version of critical rationalism seems to have lost its way. By limiting himself so severely to logical analysis and neglecting the methodological aspects of rationality, Miller gives his philosophy a characteristic typical of positivism; by limiting his considerations to logic, he suggests that almost anything goes.

Theoretical frameworks are needed to direct rational thought and conduct, and methodological rules are needed to improve criticism and to maintain critical standards. Popper took over from the psychology of Otto Selz the idea that rational thought is directed because it is problem-oriented: without problems to direct thought it becomes a random process. And without frameworks we cannot formulate and choose problems well.

Miller can defend his view by explaining that he, too, recommends procedures to select theories to consider true. This takes us back to the problems of social standards of rationality, of problem-solving, of desiderata and of methods of critique which other critical rationalists are engaged in solving. About all this he remains silent. Yet his view that there are no good reasons for considering some statements true seems to render these redundant. If they are redundant, he should explain how we can do without them; if not, he is saying what most critical rationalists agree about.

8. Critical Rationalism, Truth and Best Theories

Alan Musgrave, Volker Gadenne and John Watkins all came out of Popper’s circle. But Musgrave and Gadenne nevertheless focus on the search for some assurance that the theories they trust really are trustworthy; Watkins wants some empirical standard to determine which theory is now the best. Their peculiarity is that they seek methods of selecting credible theories or the best theories, while recognizing the validity of the criticisms of methods of justification launched by critical rationalists.

Musgrave endorses Popper’s arguments that show the impossibility of sensible assignments to theories of some measure of probability. But he finds wanting Popper’s way of avoiding skepticism, because Popper fails to offer reasons for beliefs. Only if it does that can Popper respond to the charge that his view is too skeptical. Musgrave regards his effort, then, as a vital defense of critical rationalism. In order to provide the needed defense, he seeks a standard for reasonable belief. He says that Popper has such a solution: we should believe that that theory which has best withstood criticism is true. He adds that Popper should have said so more clearly.

Skepticism is the theory that no theory is any better than any other. Critical rationalism offers tentative rules for the choice of theories to examine, not to believe in. Musgrave endorses Popper’s criticism of all attempts to specify the probability of any theory being true. He considers his position fallibilist and critical rationalist, because he accepts evidence to justify belief in a theory only if the evidence results from attempts to refute it. And, he claims, no evidence justifies claims that a theory is true, but only belief in a theory. Belief in a theory that has withstood criticism is justified, then, but not the claim that it is true. It is not clear why Musgrave suggests that the task of justifying beliefs is less insoluble and less superfluous than that of justifying theories.

Volker Gadenne resembles Musgrave somewhat. He agrees with Popper that theoretical science may very well do without evidence for belief, but he disagrees with him about actions: these require decisions as to which hypothesis is best. He suggests, then, that confirmed theories are preferable as a pragmatic ground for belief. Unlike Musgrave, he realizes that Popper’s theory of corroboration cannot serve this purpose, as it allots the least probable theories, the ones that take the most risks, the highest degree of corroboration. But acting on them is still most risky. He therefore has a different theory of corroboration. He separates content from degree of corroboration in order to justify choosing the most highly corroborated theories to guide actions.

Admittedly we do need standards to limit the risk of the application of theories, as Agassi has pointed out. As a matter of principle, Agassi notes, we may demand that theories be tested in severe ways in order to reduce risk. But this procedure is not designed to increase belief or confidence in hypotheses or likelihood of theories. (It is not clear what Gadenne claims for corroboration.) For example, two theories might be equally applicable to some practical situation, one of which may by more risky, because it has more consequences than its competitor. We may still prefer it as a basis for action, even though we have, according to Gadenne’s theory, more reason to believe the weaker theory. The stronger theory may enable us to do more. We have, for example, introduced nuclear energy even though we have far less reason, on Gadenne’s standards for belief, to believe that using nuclear power is less risky than using coal. We use gene-technology for various purposes, even though Gadenne’s theory of belief offers reasons to refrain from using it. We thus have standards for application of theories in technology and other areas of life which are quite independent of belief, thus apparently refuting Gadenne’s theory.

Gadenne might respond by contending that the belief in question is not belief in a theory but belief in the success of its application. So, before applying it, we try to increase our belief that the application will succeed. But this is also not the case. We seek to anticipate problems and to test, as well as we can, whether some given application will lead to success or not. We try to apply risky theories because they promise more. When we know we are taking considerable risks, we anticipate them as best we can, and prepare to change course quickly. When we do not anticipate risks, but hope for great success, we simply act to test our hopes. The realization that these always may be frustrated may lead to total paralysis on the basis of Gadenne’s theory of the need for corroboration as a means of choice of theories that enable us to act. Planning to solve our problems and realize our hopes employs theories with explanatory power. It also takes into account criticism of possible courses of action, and requires decisions. Belief or reassurance or corroboration are not required. Gadenne’s theory, just like Musgrave’s, leads us back to numerous insoluble and superfluous problems in the search for justification: How much corroboration must we seek before we act?

Judges must justify the sentences they impose on criminals. Proposals to take risks with the environment or to defend it should be justified too─on a case by case basis. Social standards have to be sufficiently agreed upon to allow for a consensus. On the core doctrine of critical rationalism, such standards cannot have epistemological justification; they are based on conjectures as to how we can avoid mistakes, and when there are different candidates, they are all subject to criticism. More cannot be done, and so all decisions are unjustified and so they all incur risks.

John Watkins intended his theory to go beyond Popper’s suggestion that we should choose the theory that has the highest degree of explanatory power. He wished to explain why the theory corroborated to the highest degree is the best now available. But it is hard to see why one theory has to be identified as the best. It is often the case that one theory will be better in one respect and another in some other respect. Such a situation poses problems for both theories. It is reasonable to attempt to solve problems facing each theory quite independently of which theory is now the best on available evidence—if indeed, such a judgment can be made in any sensible way. The attempt to reduce all the good qualities to one quality which is fundamental or the most important is quixotic, as Popper’s failed attempt to reduce all good qualities of theory to high degree of testability illustrates. (In the development of his theory of metaphysical research programs Agassi first pointed out that explanatory power can vary independently from testability.) The refined theory of corroboration which Watkins offers is quite irrelevant to practice, where what counts is adequacy for the task at hand and not some abstract measure of current success. Also, in practice we do not want to know which theory is the best, but how various serious alternatives may be improved. Furthermore, there is no point in trying to say which theory is the best at any given time with such a difficult procedure as Watkins has offered: before we have determined which of two alternatives is the best, both alternatives will very likely have been modified and we will have to start all over again.

Theories should have good qualities before we set about criticizing them, if we are not to waste our time in a random search. These good qualities are methodological: What does the theory explain? What problems does it solve? How can it be criticized? They are not epistemological: What evidence do we have for its truth? How can we be reassured we are on the right track? How do we know it corresponds to what the truth is like? Watkins views himself as a critical rationalist even though he stresses corroboration, because he does not relate corroboration to appraisals of the truth or probability of theories, but rather to other good qualities of theories. But he changes the project of critical rationalism from substituting methods of criticism for methods of justification to the quixotic project of determining which theory is best at any given time on the basis of its corroboration.

9. Critical Rationalist Sociology of Science

A crucial feature of critical rationalism is the theory that social norms determine the degree of rationality which individuals are able to exercise. This is a direct outgrowth of Popper’s use of methodological rules to explain the growth of science. Because science is a social activity, Popper argued, Robinson Crusoe could not do science. One individual, he suggested, cannot both put forth and criticize theories adequately. Rationality comes from cooperation. To be effective in bringing about the growth of knowledge, criticism should follow social rules.

This feature of critical rationalism has led to a critical rationalist sociology of science and technology. The task of this sociology is the appraisal of the rules of science and technology. Do they encourage or hinder the formulation and circulation of bold conjectures and their effective critical appraisal? This effort began with Agassi’s criticisms of Popper’s rule to always prefer the theory with the highest degree of testability: Sometimes a testable theory has a higher explanatory power than some competitor, he argued, but also has a lower degree of testability than this competitor. We may, then, prefer it. The same holds for Popper’s rule that all basic statements used in science should be repeatable: an independently testable explanation of a basic statement is sufficient. From these studies he moved on to inquiries into science as an open society. Even in the face of the traditional association of science with openness of debate and discussion, a variety of modern thinkers such as Michael Polanyi and Thomas Kuhn have opposed this view.

John Wettersten has continued critical rationalist studies in the sociology of science with examinations of how adventurous and conservative styles of research complement and compete with each other, how stylistic standards can hinder research, how a problem-oriented approach may improve standards in science and technology, and how critical rationalism may be used to guide sociological research. Wettersten has developed critical studies of alternative approaches to the sociology of science: a critical rationalist approach aims at minimizing the idealization of science, but without explaining scientific knowledge away.

I.C. Jarvie has recently studied how and when Popper added a theory of the institutions of science to his theory of the logic of science (Jarvie 2001) . In The Open Society and Its Enemies Popper explicitly added a social dimension to his view of science which was only implicit in Logik der Forschung. Popper did not, however, move on to sociological studies of science. He was so concerned not to explain away scientific knowledge as a mere social phenomena that he did not engage in the social studies of science even though his view called for such studies. He did not see that the effort to minimize idealized versions of science by describing how science encourages and hinders research poses no temptation to explain away scientific knowledge.

10. Philosophical Anthropology and Critical Rationality

As rationality is never perfect, and as idealization is to be minimized, Jarvie and Agassi tried to solve a number of central issues in the social sciences under the assumption that rationality is a matter of degree. This invites a new philosophical anthropology. In order to understand human nature it is desirable to desist from seeking all-or-nothing theories of humanity as, for example, a mere machine or of rationality as perfect. Human rationality cannot be understood apart from its mechanical or biological or social or rational aspects; human mechanism and biology and society cannot be understood apart from their rational aspects.

11. Critical Rationalism and Political Society

In addition to being a study of the methodology of the social sciences Popper’s The Open Society and Its Enemies is a political manifesto. It sets minimal conditions for democratic politics: it must avoid utopian social engineering. The exclusive use of piecemeal social engineering requires that societies be open and that critical appraisal of government policies be carried out. Governments must set abstract conditions for how a society functions, but they should leave individuals free to act as they choose. This freedom includes the right of individuals to build their own social groups.

John Watkins and Bryan Magee have added significant observations about Popper’s contribution. Watkins pointed out that Popper’s theory offered a basis for a pluralistic society which traditional theories of rationality cannot: justificationist theories allow only one view to be justified given the evidence at any time, whereas critical rationalism allows for a range of defensible theories which may democratically compete in the political arena. Magee (1995) has argued that Popper’s philosophy offered a good antidote for those who would reject existing society as no good on the basis of utopian standards and demand radical reform. It explained why all societies have grave defects, that they could be corrected to some degree piecemeal, but that no radical change of society had any hope of making the situation any better.

Popper’s abstract demarcation of closed and open societies does not touch most political controversies today, which concern disagreements among defenders of the open society. As a consequence, critical rationalists such as Jeremy Shearmur and Gerard Radnitzky have attempted to pull Popper’s theory toward Hayek and laissez-faire economics, whereas others, such Malachi Hacohen, Agassi and Helmut Schmidt have found in his theory a framework for theories of active social reform. Popper said very little about competing democratic forms of government and what he has said is not necessarily connected to his philosophical deliberations in any obvious way.

Popper’s observation that reform has unintended and unknown consequences which may then require further adjustments or backtracking has been read as a support for Hayek’s demand that all government should be severely limited. Popper’s observation that no society is perfect and his demand that social reform should eliminate some of its worst aspects have been read as support of a moderate socialism.

12. Popper and Education Theory

Popper began his research as a student of the Pedagogical Institute of the University of Vienna. Members of the Würzburg School such as Karl Bühler and Otto Selz were closely associated with the school reform movement led by Eduard Burger. Selz explained how learning could be improved when it centred on active problem solving. Popper adopted his view and argued that the memorization of important material by repetition would be replaced with a Selzian, problem-orientated approach. Wettersten has explained this as a beginning of integrated psychology and pedagogy that Popper has further developed by adding to it his methodological insights. Other critical rationalists followed this lead stressing the import of active problem solving, and adding the formation of conjectures and exercises in criticism and improvement of them. Also, emphasizing Popper’s insight that science only makes advances in social settings, they have added the demand not to ignore the fact that learning involves social interaction, whereby autonomy, as the needed prerequisite for critical thinking, is also deemed a prime goal of any good pedagogy.

13. Conclusion

The salient points of critical rationalism open new possibilities in ethics, which until now has been merely couched in terms of the need to be critical and open. A problem-oriented ethics may replace traditional rule and consequence oriented ones. The use of critical standards of debate to appraise the history of philosophy opens up new perspectives as illustrated in the work of Curtis on Darwin’s reception (Curtis 1987) and Wettersten’s study of the reception to Whewell. It offers new paths for the study of related fields such as economics, where Kurt Klappholz and Lawrence Boland have led the way, for the study of methods and historiography of psychology as mentioned, and the possibility of a new theory of institutions as structures which individuals use to solve problems and appraise alternatives.

Various efforts such as these are still too fresh to be appraised and various defenders of critical rationalism differ on crucial issues. Just what, if any, its long-term impact will be is still quite open; debates among its exponents and between them and opponents are still on-going. The crucial issue is whether and to what degree methods of criticism can be substituted for epistemological methods of justification in all areas of life. This is the way we can face the stimulating criticism of Russell, who viewed critical rationalism as defeatist. Only the exhibition of bold, fruitful thinking may answer it. There is ongoing research to develop a critical theory of the history of philosophy, of the sociology of science, of political philosophy, of ethical theory, and of social and political institutions. If critical rationalism is merely a theory of weak justification as Musgrave, Gadenne and Watkins would have it, or if it ignores problems of the direction of research and intellectual standards as perhaps Hattiangadi, Andersson and Miller do, then it may deservedly be forgotten.

14. References and Further Reading

The literature on critical rationalism is enormous. Manfred Lubbe in his Karl R. Popper, Bibliographie 1925-2004 lists over four thousand publications on Popper. And his list omits many publications. The following bibliography is slanted to give background to the above portrayal of critical rationalism, on the one hand, and to contain a sampling of some of the most important literature, on the other. It is unavoidable that some publications which might not be so very important are listed as background, while others which may be of some significance are omitted in order to keep the list relatively short.

  • Agassi, Joseph, Towards an Historiography of Science, History and Theory, Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Beiheft 2, (1963).
  • Agassi, Joseph, Science in Flux (Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publ. Co., 1975).
  • Agassi, Joseph , Towards a Rational Philosophical Anthropology (The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1977).
  • Agassi, Joseph, Science and Society (Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publ. Co., 1981).
  • Agassi, Joseph, Technology: Philosophical and Social Aspects (Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publ. Co., 1985).
  • Agassi, Joseph, A Philosopher’s Apprentice: In Karl Popper’s Workshop (Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi, 1993).
  • Agassi, Joseph and Jarvie, I.C. (eds) Rationality: The Critical View (Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff Publishers, 1987).
  • Albert, Hans, Traktat über kritscher Vernunft (Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck Verlag, 1968).
  • Albert, Hans, Plädoyer für kritischen Rationalismus (München: Piper Verlag, 1971).
  • Albert, Hans, Konstruktion und Kritik (Hoffmann und Campe Verlag, 1972).
  • Albert, Hans, Traktat über rationale Praxis (Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck Verlag, 1978).
  • Albert, Hans, Kritischer Vernunft und menschlicher Praxis (Stuttgart: Philipp Verlag jun. Verlag, 1984).
  • Albert, Hans, Treatise on Critical Reason (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985).
  • Albert, Hans, Marktsoziologie und Entscheidungslogik (Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck Verlag, 1998).
  • Bartley, William Bartley, The Retreat to Commitment (London: Chatto and Windus, 1964).
  • Berkson, William and Wettersten, John, Lernen aus dem Irrtum, Forward by Hans Albert (Hamburg: Hoffmann und Campe Verlag, l982).
  • Berkson, William and Wettersten, John, Learning from Error, English edition of Berkson and Wettersten l982 (La Salle: Open Court Publishing Co., l984).
  • Boland, Lawrence A, The Foundations of Economic Method (London: George Allen & Unwin, 1982).
  • Bunge, Mario (ed.) The Critical Approach to Science and Philosophy (Glencoe: The Free Press, 1964).
  • Bunge, Mario, “Instant Autobiography”, Studies on Mario Bunge’s Treatise, eds. Paul Weigartner and Georg J.W. Dorn, Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi, 1990, 677-684
  • Curtis, Ron, Darwin as an Epistemologist. Annals of Science 44, 379-408.
  • Elliot, Benjamin, Falsifiable Statements in Theology: Karl Popper and Christian Thought, Karl Popper Essay Prize, 2004.
  • Gadenne, Volker, ed. Kritischer Rationalismus und Pragmatismus, Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi, 1998.
  • Fried, Yehuda, and Agassi, Joseph, Paranoia: A Study in Diagnosis (Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publ. Co., 1976).
  • Hattiangadi, Jagdish, “Methodology without methodological rules,” in: R.S. Cohen and M.W. Wartofsky (eds), Language logic and method, Boston Studies in the Philosophy of Science (Dordrecht: Kluwer 1982), pp. 103-51.
  • Jarvie, I.C., The Revolution in Anthropology (London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1964).
  • Jarvie, I.C., The Republic of Science (Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi, 2001)
  • Jarvie, I.C. and Laor, Nathaniel (eds), Metaphysics and Science (Dordrecht, Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1994).
  • Jarvie, I.C. and Laor, Critical Rationalism, the Social Sciences and the Humanities (Dordrecht, Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1994).
  • Klappholtz, Kurt and Joseph Agassi, ‘Methodological Prescriptions in Economics’, Economica (Feb. 9, 1959): 60-74.
  • Koetsier, Teun, Lakatos’ Philosophy of Mathematics: An Historical Approach (Amsterdam: North Holland, 1991).
  • Lubbe, Manfred, (ed.) Karl R. Popper, Bibliographie 1925-2004 (Frankfurt: Peter Lang, 2005).
  • Lakatos, Imré, Proofs and Refutations: The Logic of Mathematical Discovery, John Worral and Elie Zahar (eds) (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1976).
  • Magee, Bryan, “What Use Is Popper to a Politician,” in Anthony O’Hear (Ed.), Karl Popper: Philosophy and Problems (Cambridge: Cambridge Universty Press 1995), pp. 259-273. Reprinted in Ian C. Jarvie and Sandra Pralong (eds), Popper’s Open Society after Fifty Years: The Continuing Relevance of Karl Popper (London: Routledge 1998), pp. 146-158.
  • Marchi, Peggy, “Mathematics as a Critical Enterprise” in R.S. Cohen, P.K. Feyerabend and M.W. Waratofsky (eds), Essays in Memory of Imré Lakatos (Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publ. Co. 1976) pp. 379-394.
  • Miller, David, Critical Rationalism (LaSalle: Open Court, 1994).
  • Musgrave, Alan, Common Sense, Science and Skepticism (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993).
  • Popper, Karl, „Ein Kriterium des empirischen Charakters theoretischer Systeme,“ Erkenntnis 1 (1932-33), 426-27.
  • Popper, Karl, Logik der Forschung, Siebente Auflage (Tübingen: J.C.B. Mohr(Paul Siebeck), 1982).
  • Popper, Karl, The Logic of Scientific Discovery (London: Hutchinson & Co., 1962).
  • Popper, Karl, The Poverty of Historicism (London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1960).
  • Popper, Karl, Objective Knowledge (Oxford: The Clarendon Press, 1972).
  • Popper, Karl, Conjectures and Refutations (New York: Basic Books, 1963, 1965).
  • Popper, Karl, Die beiden Grundprobleme der Erkenntnistheorie (Tübingen: J.C.B. Mohr(Paul Siebeck), 1979).
  • Popper, Karl, The Open Society and Its Enemies, Fourth Edition (New York: Harper & Row, 1962).
  • Popper, Karl, “The Rationality Principle,” in: David Miller (ed.) Popper Selections (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985), pp. 357ff.
  • Popper, Karl, Gesammelte Werke. Band 1: Frühe Schriften. Hrsg. v. Troels E. Hansen. (Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck, 2006.)
  • Reichenbach, Hans, Erkenntnis, 1 (192-33), 426-7.
  • Selz, Otto, Über die Gesetze des geordneten Denkversaufs, eine experimentelle Untersuchung. Erste Teil (Stuttgart: Spemann, 1913).
  • Selz, Otto, Über die Gesetze des geordneten Denkverlaufs, Zweiter Teil, Zur Psychologie des produktiven Denkens und des Irrtums. Eine experimentelle Untersuchung, (Bonn: Cohen, 1922).
  • Shearmur, Jeremy, Hayek and After, Hayekian liberalism as a research program (London: Routledge, 1996).
  • Spalt, Detlef D., Vom Mythos der mathematischen Vernunft (Darmstadt: wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft, 1981)
  • Watkins, J. W. N., Science and Skepticism (London: Hutschison; Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984).
  • Watkins, J. W. N., “Imperfect Rationality” in R. Borger and F. Cioffi (eds) Explanation in the Behavioral Sciences (Cambridge: Cambridge Univ. Press, 1970), pp. 167-217.
  • Wisdom, J.O., “The Analyst Controversy: Berkeley’s influence on the development of mathematics,” Hermathema 54, (1939): 3-29.
  • Wisdom, J.O., “The Compensation of Errors in the Methods of Fluxions,” Hermathema 57 (1941): 3-29.
  • Wettersten, John, “The Place of Bunge” in Joseph Agassi and Robert S. Cohen (Eds) Scientific Philosophy Today (Dordrecht, Boston, London: D. Reidel, l982a) pp. 465-86.
  • Wettersten, John, The Roots of Critical Rationalism, Schriftenreihe zur Philosophie Karl R. Poppers und des kritischen Rationalismus, Kurt Salamun (Ed.) (Amsterdam und Atlanta: Rodopi, 1992a).
  • Wettersten, John, ‘The Sociology of Scientific Establishments Today’, British Journal of Sociology, 44, 1 (1993): 68-102.
  • Wettersten, John, “Braucht die Wissenschaft methodologische Regeln?” Conceptus, Wettersten, John “After Popper,” Review-essay of David Miller, Critical Rationalism and Alan Musgrave, Common Sense, Science and Skepticism, Philosophy of the Social Sciences, 26, 1 (1996b): 92-112.
  • Wettersten, John, “Eine aktuelle Aufgabe für den kritischen Rationalismus und die Soziologie,” in Hans-Jürgen Wendel und Volker Gadenne (eds) Kritik und Rationalität (Tübingen: J.C.B. Mohr(Paul Siebeck) 1996c), pp. 183-212.
  • Wettersten, John, “The Critical Rationalists’ Quest for an Effective Liberal Pedagogy,” in Gerhard Zecha, Critical Rationalism and Educational Discourse (Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi:, 1999a), pp. 93-115.
  • Wettersten, John, “Popper’s Historical Role: Innovative Dissident,” Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie, Vol. 36, No. 1, Jan. 2005, 119-133.
  • Wettersten, John, “New Insights on Young Popper,” Journal for The History of Ideas, (Oct. 2005); pp. 603-631.
  • Wettersten, John, How Do Institutions Steer Events? An Inquiry into the Limits and Possibilities of Rational Thought and Action (Aldershot: Ashgate Publ. Co., 2006)
  • Zecha, Gerhard, ed., Critical Rationalism and Educational Discourse (Amsterdam and Atlanta: Rodopi, 1999).

Author Information

John R. Wettersten
Email: wettersten@t-online.de
Mannheim Universit
Germany

Peter Abelard (1079—1142)

abelardPeter Abelard (1079-1142) was the preeminent philosopher of the twelfth century and perhaps the greatest logician of the middle ages. During his life he was equally famous as a poet and a composer, and might also have ranked as the preeminent theologian of his day had his ideas earned more converts and less condemnation. In all areas Abelard was brilliant, innovative, and controversial. He was a genius. He knew it, and made no apologies. His vast knowledge, wit, charm, and even arrogance drew a generation of Europe’s finest minds to Paris to learn from him.

Philosophically, Abelard is best known as the father of nominalism. For contemporary philosophers, nominalism is most closely associated with the problem of universals but is actually a much broader metaphysical system. Abelard formulated what is now recognized as a central nominalist tenet: only particulars exist. However, his solution to the problem of universals is a semantic account of the meaning and proper use of universal words. It is from Abelard’s claim that only words (nomen) are universal that nominalism gets its name. Abelard would have considered himself first a logician and then later in his life a theologian and ethicist. He may well have been the best logician produced in the Middle Ages. Several innovations and theories that are conventionally thought to have originated centuries later can be found in his works. Among these are a theory of direct reference for nouns, an account of purely formal validity, and a theory of propositional content once thought to have originated with Gottlob Frege. In ethics, Abelard develops a theory of moral responsibility based on the agent’s intentions. Moral goodness is defined as intending to show love of God and neighbor and being correct in that intention.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works
  2. Universals
  3. Metaphysics
  4. Logic and Philosophy of Language
  5. Cognition and Philosophy of Mind
  6. Ethics
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. General Surveys
    2. Life
    3. Universals
    4. Logic, Metaphysics, and Philosophy of Mind
    5. Ethics
    6. William of Champeaux

1. Life and Works

Peter Abelard was born the eldest son of lesser nobility in La Pallet in Brittany. In 1092, around the age of 13, Abelard gave up his inheritance and knighthood and began an extraordinary philosophical education with the greatest philosophical and theological minds of his day: Roscelin of Compiegne (from 1092-1099), William of Champeaux (from 1100-1102 and 1108-1110), and Anselm of Laon (in 1113). Although each of these men was at the peak of his intellectual reputation, Abelard quickly became disenchanted with them all. He moved first from Roscelin to William and then, believing he could do better, set up his first school at Melun in 1102. He ran this school successfully for two years until he was forced to return to Brittany. He claims this was due to ill health. Recent biographers have speculated that it had more to do with political turmoil involving his patron Stephen de Garlande. In 1108 he returned to Paris to study again with William. Conflict was probably inevitable between the established scholar who held the reputation for being the leading intellectual in Paris and the young genius who felt he deserved an even greater crown. Between 1108 and 1110 Abelard and William had their famous disputes over the nature of universals. Abelard claims to have driven William from the schools of Paris in shame. In fact, William left Paris to become a Bishop of Châlon-sur-Marne and Papal ambassador to the court of Emperor Henry V. This is perhaps not as shameful as Abelard suggests, but William’s views on universals have never since been seriously held by another philosopher.

Abelard continued to teach successfully until 1113 when he left to study theology with Anselm of Laon. Abelard was equally disenchanted by Anselm, but not quite so lucky in this dispute. Abelard set himself up as a competing lecturer. He attracted many of Anselm’s students to himself, but earned the enduring enmity of others. Anselm’s aggrieved disciples dogged Abelard his entire career. They quickly acquired St. Bernard of Clairvaux as their champion. Bernard needed little convincing. He took offence at Abelard’s attempt to apply the tools of logic and dialectic to questions Bernard felt were properly mystical and spiritual. Twice Bernard orchestrated councils where Abelard’s works were condemned. At Soissons (1122) Abelard was forced to ceremonially burn his own book the Theologia Summi Boni. At Sens (1140) a revised version, the Theologia Scholarium, was again condemned and Abelard and his followers were excommunicated.

These condemnations were in the future when Abelard returned to Paris in 1113 to take up the chair at Notre Dame that had been vacated by William of Champeaux. Once again Abelard taught successfully, for a few years. In 1116 or thereabouts Abelard began an affair with Heloise his student and the niece of Fulbert the canon of Notre Dame. She was to become one of the great minds of the twelfth century in her own right, and theirs is the great tragic love story of the middle ages. They fell in love, had a child, secretly married, and exchanged a series of love letters that have become the stuff of legend. Unfortunately, they kept their marriage a secret from Fulbert. Heloise’s uncle exercised the traditional right of aggrieved families in such cases and had Abelard castrated.

For the next ten years, Abelard undertook an unsuccessful career as a monk. Because of his reputation many monasteries wanted to claim him as their own. Because of his personality this rarely worked out well. He left St. Denis after “proving” that the monastery’s founder (also the patron saint of France) could not be the St. Denis that they claimed but rather was a different and less significant St. Denis. In 1126 he was appointed abbot of St. Gildas. He had been elected by the brothers based on his flamboyant reputation. They were bitterly disappointed to get in Abelard a strident reformer of monastic discipline. Abelard claims that the monks tried to kill him.

Abelard returned to Paris for the last time in 1133 where he taught and wrote until the council of Sens in 1141. St. Bernard had diligently worked behind the scenes to ensure that Abelard and his works would be condemned. Recognizing that the council was not a forum to debate ideas but rather a panel assembled to confirm a pre-established conclusion, Abelard was famously silent when questioned. He appealed the decision directly to the Pope in Rome. Once again Bernard’s superior connections and diplomatic skills won out. Before Abelard could even leave France, Bernard had already orchestrated a pronouncement from the Pope upholding the council’s decision. The Pope lifted the excommunication, but Abelard was condemned to silence. Abelard lived out his days under the protection of Peter the Venerable Abbot of Cluny. He died on April 21, 1142 and was buried at the Paraclete, the abbey he had founded with Heloise. Today Abelard and Heloise’s bodies are interred at Père Lachaise cemetery in Paris.

Abelard’s best known writings are his autobiography the Historia Calamitatum (The Story of my Misfourtunes), the letters he exchanged with Heloise, and the Sic et Non. The Historia, written after Abelard’s escape from St. Gildas, details Abelard’s rise to fame and the misfortunes of his fall. It is addressed to an unidentified friend with the hope that this friend will feel better about his own suffering after reading of Abelard’s. The real purpose was likely to remind people of Abelard’s past fame and to pave the way for a return to Paris. The letters of Abelard and Heloise discuss issues ranging from their relationship to theological and philosophical matters affecting Heloise’s nuns at the Paraclete. In the past century there was considerable debate about the authenticity of these letters, or at least about Heloise’s letters. It is now generally accepted that the letters are authentic, and that Heloise was as formidable a personality in real life as she appears in her letters. The Sic et Non does not strictly speaking contain any of Abelard’s original thought. Rather, Abelard collected a list of 158 controversial theological questions and compiled writings from authorities some for (“Sic“), some opposed (“Non“). The reader should be able to dissolve the apparent conflict between authorities and come to understand the answers to the questions posed through rational discussion.

Abelard’s works in logic and metaphysics were written mostly in those periods he was teaching in and around Paris. The result is Abelard’s earliest work, is a series of glosses called the Introductiones Parvulorum (ca. 1100-1104). These are almost line by line explanations of the standard logical texts available in the Latin West: Porphyry’s Isagoge, Boethius’ De hypotheticis syllogismis and De topicis differentiis, and Aristotle‘s Categories and De interpretatione. These close textual commentaries show how much Abelard’s early thought was influenced by his first teacher Roscelin. Abelard explains these texts—even the Categories—as being about words and language not things in the world. In his second stint teaching in Paris, Abelard wrote another series of commentaries on the same works, the Logica Ingredientibus, and a treatise in logic, the Dialectica (ca. 1115-1119). These works are much more expansive. It is here that Abelard develops his distinctive form of nominalism, and develops his most influential thoughts in logic. The switch from Roscelin’s vocalism, a theory of words, to his own nominalism, a theory of names, reflects a more sophisticated understanding of semantics and metaphysics developed while disputing with William. The Logica Nostrorum Petitioni Sociorum, a later commentary on Porphyry perhaps from his third stint in Paris, contains a restatement and perhaps several subtle changes in his theory of universals.

In his final period of teaching in the 1130s, Abelard turned primarily to ethics and theology. His lectures on logic were well attended but John of Salisbury suggests that late in his career Abelard was no longer on the cutting edge. Abelard’s two major ethical works—the Ethics or Know yourself and the Dialogue Between a Philosopher, a Jew, and a Christian (or Colationes)—were both written in the late 1130’s.

Over the course of his career Abelard wrote three distinct treatises on the Trinity. The sequence and progression of Abelard’s Trinitarian thought is better known than some other aspects of Abelard’s thought. The Theologia Summi Boni was condemned at the council of Soissons (1122). The Theologia Christiana (ca 1125-30) remains the most influential of the three. This is because the third the Theologia Scholarium was itself condemned at the counsel of Sens (1141), where Abelard and his followers were excommunicated. In addition to these extensive works on the Trinity, Abelard wrote several commentaries on books of the bible, soliloquies, ethical and religious poems, and studies of the various creeds.

2. Universals

Abelard is credited as the founder of nominalism for his claim that a universal is a name (nomen) or significant word (sermo). He is also credited with inspiring a school of followers called the nominales. His discussion of universals has two parts: a rejection of realism and a semantic solution to the problem of universals. In its simplest form, the problem of universals is the problem of explaining how two or more individuals are the same (or similar). Plato and Socrates are both human beings yet they are distinct individuals. A realist posits some item in the world, namely, “humanity”—a universal that is somehow shared by both Plato and Socrates. This shared universal makes both Socrates and Plato human and is the reason the word “human” applies equally to both. Abelard denies the existence of any such universal item in this realist sense. His solution to the problem of universals is a semantic account of how universal words apply to many discrete individuals when there is no universal shared by those individuals.

For the first part of his argument, Abelard generally finds it sufficient to refute particular realist arguments. The three most prominent in Abelard’s writings are (1) material essence realism and (2) indifference realism—both held by William of Champeaux—and (3) collective realism.

Material essence realism has three central theses:

(1) there are ten most general essences, one corresponding to each of Aristotle’s ten categories. These ten most general essences exist in some degree unformed.

(2) these general essences are the “matter” that is formed into sub-altern genera and species by the addition of differentia, the characteristic features that determine the species to which each type of substance belongs. The most general essence, Substance, is formed into Corporeal Substance and Incorporeal Substance by the addition of the differentiae Corporeal and Incorporeal, and so on down the tree of porphyry

(3) individuation is accomplished by the addition of accidental forms. At the species level—when substance has been differentiated into Rational, Mortal, Animate, Corporeal, Substance (Human)—the addition of accidental forms divides the material essence into discrete individuals. Socrates and Plato share exactly the same material essence of Humanity. But Plato is tall and has brown hair. Socrates is short and bald. These accidental properties make them individuals.

The individuals in a species or genus share the single material essence. This pure universal essence is never actually found in the world, but William claims “it does not go against nature for it to be a pure thing if it were to happen that all its accidents were removed.” (Marenbon 2004: 33) This exercise of stripping away the accidental forms of Socrates to arrive at pure humanity is not merely a mental exercise; it could possibly occur thereby revealing the underlying pure universal essence.

It is this principle of a single universal substance individuated by accidents that Abelard reduces to absurdity. Material essence realism makes individuation itself impossible. The accidents that are supposed to individuate substance are themselves un-individuated universal essences. The material essences in the categories of quality and quantity etc. also must be individuated by the addition of an accidental form. An accident cannot individuate substance unless that accident has been individuated first. Abelard writes “The <accidental> forms in themselves are not in essence diverse from one another…. Therefore, Socrates and Plato are no more diverse from one another because of the nature of quality than they are because of the nature of substance.” (Spade, 1994: §37) Material essence realism cannot explain the existence of discrete individuals.

In response, William formulates a second realist theory of universals. Indifference realism rejects the core principle of material essence realism: shared essences. William now accepted that it is simply a basic fact about individuals that they are completely discrete from one another. The seed of the theory is found in an ambiguity in the words “one” and “same.” William claims that, “When I say Plato and Socrates are the same I might attribute identity of wholly the same essence or I might simply mean that they do not differ in some relevant respect.” The stronger sense of “one” and “same” applies to Peter/ Simon, Saul/ Paul (we would say Cicero/Tully). As for Plato and Socrates:

We say that they are the same in that they are men, “same” pertaining with regard to humanity. Just as one is rational so is the other, just as one is mortal so is the other. But if we wanted to make a true confession it is not the same humanity in each one, but similar humanity since they are two men. (Sententiae 236.115-120)

So although Plato and Socrates have no common matter they are still called “same” because they do not differ. This leads to the claim that Abelard finds so disturbing: each individual is both universal and particular. William writes:

One Man is many men, taken particularly. Those which are one considered in a species are many considered particularly. That is to say, without accidents they are considered one per indifference, with accidents many (Iwakuma 1999 p.119).

Indifference realism is not a complete departure from material essence realism. When the accidents are stripped away, Plato and Socrates are still the same although in a weaker sense of “same.” They do not share a material essence, nonetheless they do not differ. William’s indifference realism holds that when the individuating accidents are stripped away from two individuals what you are left with may be numerically distinct but not discernable individuals. There are two of them but you cannot tell them apart or tell which one was Plato. What you are left with are pure things—there are no individuating characteristics. Each individual is itself the universal.

In his own works, Abelard did not explain indifference realism in any detail. He notes that this view is closer to the truth but he does not explain how or why. He rejects the view based on the metaphysical absurdity of the individual being the universal. On William’s second view Socrates is the species “humanity.” If Socrates, insofar as he is humanity, is the universal, then it is in fact Socrates that is predicated of Plato when we say “Plato is human.” Conversely if the species “humanity” is the individual then it cannot be a universal. By definition an individual cannot be predicated of many. To the more basic claim that Plato and Socrates are the same in that they do not differ in being man, Abelard responds that they are also the same in that they do not differ in being stone. Pointing out that things do not differ does not explain their similarity, agreement, or sameness.

The third prominent realist theory Abelard refutes is collective realism. This is the view that the entire collection of individuals contained in a species constitutes the universal. For example, the entire collection of humans would constitute the universal “Humanity.” The entire collection of animals is the universal “Animal.” And so forth. Abelard’s attack on this view is equally devastating. The central idea in his best arguments is that being an individual of a certain species or genus is metaphysically prior to inclusion in the collection. If there is a prior reason for placing an individual in one collection and not another—if there is a right and a wrong way to put individuals into species—then the collection is not doing the work of the universal. The collection is not defining genera and species, it is reflecting genera and species. If there is no such principle, then any collection of random items could be a genus and any subset of that collection would be a species. Two men, one squirrel and paper cup could be a universal. Collective realism either fails to explain what it purports to explain or adopts such radical conventionalism about ontology that it is reduced to absurdity. Abelard’s refutation of William’s realism revealed his (Abelard’s) commitment to a world populated by discrete individuals. And his refutation of collective realism reveals a belief that individuals fall into natural kinds.

The refutation of prominent realist theories leaves Abelard free to pursue the second part of his argument. Having shown that there are no universal things, he can now develop a semantic theory of universals. In his Logica Ingredientibus, Abelard approaches the subject by posing three distinct questions: What is the common cause for the imposition of universal words? What is the common conception signified by universal words? Are universal words universal because of the common cause, the common conception, or both?

The common cause for the imposition of universal words is the status. The person who imposed the universal word “human” established the convention whereby the word’s corresponding sound names each individual that has the status: being a human. In contemporary terms, Abelard holds a theory of direct reference. The universal word refers to—or nominates—each individual with the status even when speakers do not have a clear understanding of the status involved. The status itself is not an item in Abelard’s ontology. That is, it is not matter, form, or essence; it is not a part of the individual. Each individual human can be said to have the status: being a human. But equally a horse and an ass are alike in the status: not being human. Not being human is clearly not some thing shared by a horse and an ass. The status or states of being human or of not being human are basic features of the individual itself. Each human just is a human. Each horse is just not a human. It is a basic fact about individuals that each falls into a niche on the tree of Porphyry, each is of a particular kind. This is because of the way individuals are created. According to Abelard, God conceives an exemplar or model in his mind before he makes individuals. An individual’s being human is the result of an individual’s being made according to the exemplar for human beings. Analogously, a house’s being a ranch results from its being built according to certain blueprints. Being human and being a ranch are not metaphysical items distinct from the individual. It is a basic fact about individuals that each one is made according to an exemplar in the divine mind.

The common conception is the understanding signified by the universal word. The utterance of the word “human” generates an understanding in the mind of the hearer. This common conception or common understanding is the meaning of the word. In successful communication, the speaker has an act of understanding that pertains to all and only things with the status being a human (as described below). He utters the word “human” and thereby causes his hearer to have his own act of understanding that pertains to all and only things that have the status being a human. The understanding generated in the mind of the hearer pertains to the same things as the speaker’s understanding when uttering the word. These understandings are formed through a process of abstraction. From studying individual humans and honing the understanding of them, we form an understanding that pertains to each individual with a status but to no individual uniquely. The process of abstraction produces understandings that are alone (sola), bare (nuda), and pure (pura). Alone means apart from sense; we do not understand the individual as a present object of sensation. A bare understanding abstracts away some of the forms in the individual. An understanding that is alone and bare conceives of this-humanity, this-whiteness, etc. An alone and bare understanding is not yet a universal understanding. A universal understanding must be pure: it must abstract from all individuating conditions. The universal understanding generated by the word “human” conceives of just the nature, mortal rational animal, and nothing else. It pertains to all individual humans but only insofar as each is human. The understanding contains nothing by which one individual could be picked out over any other. These alone, bare, and pure understandings can approximate the exemplars in the divine mind sufficiently for the imposition and use of language. However, because we must learn by studying the created individuals our human understandings will always fall short of knowledge. We will never understand natures and properties as well as the creator.

The primacy of the individual is the central element in Abelard’s theory. Unless and until individuals with a particular status are created, we cannot form an understanding of their nature or impose a word to name them. This limitation is not an accident of our imperfect epistemic position. In a way that Abelard finds disturbing, the same holds for God.

But a question now arises about the builder’s (God’s) plan: Is it empty ‘false or meaningless’ while he now holds in mind the form of the future work, then the thing is not that way yet?… If someone calls it “empty” on the grounds that it would not yet be in harmony with the status of the future thing, we shudder at the awful words, but do not reject the judgment. For it is true that the future status of the world did not materially exist while God was intelligibly arranging what was still future. (Spade, 1994: §135)

Before he creates roses even God’s alone, bare, and pure understanding of the nature rose is empty. Presumably, were God to attempt to use the word “rose” under these conditions his word would not name any thing, and no one would know what he was talking about.

Discussion of the problem of universals in the early middle ages was framed by Porphyry’s three questions: (a) whether genera and species are real or are situated in bare thoughts alone, (b) whether as real they are bodies or incorporeals, and (c) whether they are separated or in sensibles and have their reality in connection with them. These questions had clearly been formulated with a realist answer in mind. After some not too subtle spin in answering Porphyry’s questions Abelard adds a fourth.

Do ‘universals’ so long as they are ‘universals’ necessarily have some thing subject to them by nomination? Or alternatively, even if the things named are destroyed, can the universal consist even then in the signification of the understanding alone? For example, the name “rose” when there are no roses to which it is common. (Spade 1994: §10)

Abelard’s answer is “no.” When there are no roses then the word “rose” is no longer a universal word; it no longer names (or nominates) many discrete individuals. The word “rose”, when uttered, would still generate an understanding which would pertain to all roses were the roses to return. When all the roses are gone the sentence “There are no roses” would be both meaningful and true. The understanding, although preserving the meaning of the universal term, is not the universal. When the individuals are destroyed the word is no longer universal.

3. Metaphysics

The fundamental commitment behind Abelard’s nominalism, that there is nothing that is not individual (or at least particular), is the conceptual core of all his metaphysical thought. Abelard held that the individual is primary, ontologically basic, and requires no explanation. It is notoriously difficult to prove such a claim. If Abelard could be said to have a metaphysical project it would be to show that other “items” that more promiscuous philosophers would add to their ontology can be reductively explained in terms of individuals (or at least of particulars).

Abelard asserts that individuals are integral wholes, and he adopts the language of form-matter composites to describe individuals, but the form is nothing other than the arrangement of the parts that comprise the whole. (cf. LI cat 79ff) Abelard holds a doctrine of double creation. God first created the four basic elements and then combined the four basic elements into various individuals according to the exemplars in his mind (LI cat 298ff; D 419ff). Only God has this power to assemble parts into a single discrete individual substance. Only God can impose form on matter (D 419). It makes perfect sense for Abelard to talk about forms, but the form is not a part of the individual. This is the hallmark of Abelard’s reductivism; “form” is a name for an objectively discernable feature of the individual, not for an ontologically distinct item.

Individuals thus created are discreet from all others; they share no matter or form, yet they are similar. Abelard will explain this in terms of natures or substantial forms, but again prefers a reductive account. Individuals have a certain nature because they have a certain substantial form, but this substantial form is not a part of the individual or any item that could be shared by two individuals. In contemporary terms Abelard would be a resemblance nominalist. Individuals created by God according to the same exemplar will be naturally similar in the way that houses made according to the same blueprint are similar. This similarity is real, not conventional, but nothing in addition to the individuals is required to explain this fact. The individuals that populate the world fall into natural kinds. Natures themselves do not need to be posited to explain this fact about the world.

Abelard provides many similar reductive accounts. Time reduces to nothing other than the individuals whose duration is measured. Relations are nothing more than the properties of the discreet individuals involved. Abelard’s reductive accounts can be quite convoluted but the basic metaphysical commitment is consistent. His most difficult case is with the dictum asserted by a declarative sentence. He could not find a way to reduce false dicta and counterfactual dicta to extant individuals, but he asserts repeatedly that dicta are “wholly nothing” and “no essence at all.”

4. Logic and Philosophy of Language

In the introductions and preambles to his various works, Abelard writes that a student should proceed from the study of words to the study of propositions—all with the goal of learning about argument. In addition to the semantic theories described above, Abelard developed a theory of propositional content thought to have originated with Frege; a theory of formal validity for syllogisms; and an as yet not well understood theory of true conditionals that differs from the account of syllogisms.

The study of words begins with the initial imposition of words. As new items are encountered, the creator of the language imposes a conventional sound to name that thing, or some nature or property of that thing. The word refers to the item directly by naming or nominating it. Naming directly picks out the item even if the imposer does not fully understand the individual, nature, or property named or even if he or she does not think about it completely correctly. In fact, Abelard writes that the imposer and subsequent users of the word may be completely ignorant of how to correctly understand the nature or property by virtue of which individuals are named by the word—as is the case with the word “stone”—and yet successfully name the individual or individuals the word was imposed to name.

Abelard assigns two related forms of signification to words: the signification of understandings and the signification of things. These two significations provide the meaning or content of the words. A spoken word signifies an understanding by generating an act of understanding in the mind of some hearer. This understanding generated should be the same as the understanding in the mind of the speaker, that is, both the speaker’s and hearer’s understanding of the same individual, nature, or property should correspond. The word is said to signify the thing that is the object of the act of understanding. Abelard is quite clear and explicit in arguing that the word does not signify a mental image or a concept. The spoken word causes the hearer to have an act of understanding—to think about—the individual, nature, or property that the speaker used the word to name. (The understanding of a nature or property pertains to all individuals with the nature or property and so is of individuals but not of any one individual uniquely.)

Abelard’s discussion of words is undertaken with an eye towards sentences. The sentence is a combination of words and so what is signified by the sentence is, in a qualified sense, composed of what is signified by the words. Abelard will call the understanding generated by a sentence “composite” but this means only that the hearer’s understanding is assembled piece by piece as he hears the words of the sentence. The “thing” signified by the sentence however is not composed of the things signified by the individual words. Rather, a declarative sentence signifies what is asserted to be the case. This is not a state of affairs nor is it a proposition if the latter is thought of as some item in the ontology. Abelard calls this the dictum; the declarative sentence “Socrates sits” signifies as its dictum that Socrates sits. The sentence is true or false if what it asserts to be the case actually is the case.

A declarative sentence signifies its dictum by asserting it, but not all sentences are declarative. With a slight change in intonation the sentence “Socrates sits” can be uttered as a question. The propositional content of the declarative sentence and the question are the same. Uttered as a declarative sentence, it is asserted that Socrates sits; a dictum is signified, and the sentence is either true or false. Uttered as a question, the propositional content is the same but there is no assertion that Socrates sits. There is no dictum. Abelard discusses the many different attitudes that can be taken with regard to the same propositional content and develops these ideas into a theory of propositional logic. He treats conditional sentences as assertions of the relation between the propositional content of the antecedent and consequent and not as an assertion of the truth of either. He also develops a theory of propositional negation which defines the negation of “All As are Bs” as “it is not the case that All As are Bs.” This negation extinguishes the propositional content and has no existential import. (Traditional Aristotelian negation held that the negation of “All As are Bs” is “Some As are not Bs.”)

There are several insights and innovations in Abelard’s discussion of argument, inference, and entailments. However, there is also some tension between different texts and not all Abelard’s views are well understood yet. Most worthy of note is Abelard’s distinction between perfect and imperfect entailment.

A perfect entailment—syllogism or conditional—is valid by virtue of its form. Abelard held that the canonical moods of syllogisms—and their conditionalizations—were formally valid and did not need a topic or maximal proposition to warrant the inference. Abelard’s criterion for perfect entailment is universal substitution, another insight that was thought to have originated centuries later. The syllogism

  1. All As are Bs
  2. All Bs are CsTherefore:
  3. All As are Cs

is valid for any terms substituted for A, B, and C. Nothing other than the formal logical structure is needed to warrant the entailment.

Imperfect entailments require more to warrant the inference. Here Abelard draws a further distinction between syllogisms and conditionals. The criterion for the validity of an imperfect syllogism is that it is impossible for the premises to be true and the conclusion false. However Abelard allows non-formal facts about the world (de natura rerum) to warrant the necessity of the syllogistic inference. These facts about the world are codified as topics and maximal propositions. A maximal proposition; for example, “whatever is predicated of the species is predicated of the genus” not only warrants an inference by stipulating a non-formal fact about the world, it limits the range of acceptable substitution to those terms signifying genera and their species. The necessity of a valid imperfect syllogism is found not in logic but in physics.

Abelard has a stricter criterion for conditionals. In contemporary terms, Abelard denied the deduction theorem. It is not enough that it be impossible for the antecedent to be true and the consequent false at the same time. This relationship might be accidental. For a conditional to be true it must also be the case that the understanding signified by the antecedent “contain” the understanding of the consequent. An example of a true conditional Abelard gives is, “If something is a body, it is corporeal.” Corporeality is contained in the understanding signified by the term “body” and so this conditional is true. However, “If something is a body, it is colored” is false. It is a fact about the world that every body is some color or other, but “being colored” is not contained in the understanding of body. So, while the enthymeme, “X is a body therefore X is colored” is valid, the corresponding conditional is false. His student, John of Salisbury, expressed shock that Abelard would accept some syllogisms as valid but reject their corresponding conditionals as false.

5. Cognition and Philosophy of Mind

While Abelard’s theory of mind and cognition was a foundation for his theories of universals and philosophy of language, he was not overly interested in philosophy of mind as such. His discussions of universals and signification each include a brief account of cognition. He wrote a stand-alone Treatise on Understandings with the express purpose of clarifying issues essential to his semantic theories.

Abelard considered his philosophy of mind to have been Aristotelian, but his knowledge of Aristotle on this subject was quite thin. He repeatedly echoes stock Aristotelian claims—sensation is of and through bodies, and so forth—but also rejects many core Aristotelian claims. Without recognizing it, Abelard rejects the accounts of cognition that can be found in Aristotle, most notably the accounts in De Anima and de Interpretatione. Abelard thoroughly rejects the theory (found in Aristotle’s theory in De Anima) that cognition involves the formal identity between the mind and the object understood. He argues that it would be absurd to claim that the mind becomes four sided when it thinks of a four sided tower. He also points out that one can think of several things at once while nothing could have those contrary forms at the same time. These criticisms suggest that Abelard was completely unaware of Aristotle’s account of intelligible forms. Given his own conception of form, this Aristotelian account of mind is nonsense.

Abelard also denies the view (expressed by Aristotle’s in the de Interpretatione) that cognition is the formation of representations, images or likenesses, of the object cognized. Although images are important to Abelard’s account of cognition, the image is only needed when direct cognition of the object via sense is not possible. Images are substitutes for present occurant experience. They are not necessary intermediates in the cognitive process. Nor are images in any way the object of cognition (except to think of a particular image as an image.)

In Abelard’s paradigm case of cognition, there are three steps: sensation, imagination, and understanding. Sensation is a power of the mind not a power of the animate body. Through the sense organ the mind looks out “as if through a window” at the world. When a physical object is present—and all other conditions are appropriate—sensation provides an initial “confused conception” of the object. This initial conception is confused because, as yet, the mind does not grasp the nature or any property of the object. We are aware of the object but don’t yet understand what it is. Imagination supplements the present sensation. If I see a tree at a distance through the sense of sight, I perceive the color and other proper objects of vision. Imagination adds texture and hardness and scent. Imagination can also provide the full substitute for absent objects. When sensation and/or imagination present this confused conception, the rational power of the mind can focus on the confused conception and focus its discerning attention on some nature or property of the object sensed or imagined. Abelard describes this as an act of understanding; it is the conscious and transient act of thinking about some thing or a nature or property of the thing. Abelard is explicit in claiming that the act of understanding is just a transient act of thinking about something. The understanding is not a concept. For Abelard the understanding is not the object of cognition nor is it object of knowledge (or as with some later nominalists the universal). Knowledge is the habit of having accurate acts of understanding something.

6. Ethics

Abelard’s ethical thought is found primarily in two works, the Ethics, (or Know yourself), and the Dialogue Between a Philosopher, a Christian, and a Jew (or Colationes.) Unfortunately neither of these works is complete, and because these are late works, it is not clear whether the missing sections are lost, or were never completed. What we have is the mature thought of a man who had experienced much in life and deeply believed that an ethics based on love, for God and for neighbor, is an integral part of human existence. Abelard had lived an eventful and turbulent life. His ethical writings have an intensity that one would expect from a monk infamous for his careerist pride and his tragic love affair. Like Augustine before him, Abelard understood ethics from both sides.

In the Ethics Abelard develops a form of intentionalism; moral rightness or wrongness is a function of the intentions of the agent. He develops a purely intentionalist account of moral wrongness. Yet in order to avoid the sort of subjectivism or relativism that his account might initially suggest, he asserts a more complicated account of moral rightness. Abelard’s concept of moral rightness and wrongness follows from his belief that God is both goodness and love, and we are thus commanded to love God and neighbor. Good intentions demonstrate love for God and neighbor, bad intentions scorn. Any intention to do what one believes to be wrong shows contempt for God as the source of all love and also contempt of neighbor as the proximate victim of the lack of love. One who intends to do what he believes to be good is, similarly, intending to demonstrate love. Such a person incurs no moral fault, but if he is to be truly morally good his belief must be correct.

Abelard develops a fairly complicated moral psychology in order to isolate exactly what consent and intention are and why these alone incur moral praise or blame. Abelard lists as the components of behavior (a) mental vice, (b) will or desire, (c) pleasure, (d) voluntariness, (e) consent and intention, and (f) the action or deed itself. In most cases the stars align: one has a vice, desires that the vice be satisfied, voluntarily consents with the intention of satisfying this desire, and takes pleasure in the successful completion of the bad act. For Abelard however, the only morally significant component on this list is (e) consent and intention. Each of these other components that make up immoral behavior is irrelevant to the moral assessment of the agent. The structure of Abelard’s argument is clear and direct. He argues that each of these other components is either present in morally good behavior, or absent in immoral behavior and is morally irrelevant.

Consent and intention are thus intimately connected. To consent is simply to give oneself over to what one intends. The intention is the agent’s understanding of what he is consenting to, including: the reasons for engaging in the action, his beliefs about the effects of the action, his evaluation of the morality of the action, and the end or goal the agent hopes to achieve by the action. An intention can in most cases explain why the agent undertook the action. An agent can be said to consent to an action only if he could provide an account of his intention. This is not to say that the account must be a good one. We can and do consent to all manner of actions with foolish and ill-conceived intentions.

Mental vice (a) and will or desire (b) can be dispensed with as sources of moral blame because they are beyond our control. Mental vice is simply the inclination towards evil. Some people are just born with strong natural inclinations to lust or gluttony or anger. Will or desire is a more reflective wanting of what one is inclined towards. It is not in an agent’s power to change the fact that he has vices, wants, and desires. However whether he consents to satisfy the desires is in his control. To experience pleasure (c) is not, of itself, immoral. William of Champeaux had argued that pleasure was the result of our fallen state, in Eden there was no physical pleasure thus any experience of pleasure is immoral. Before the fall sex was no more pleasurable than “putting your finger in your mouth” (Sen. 254). Abelard disagrees. We feel pleasure because God made us in such a way that some things are pleasurable. If pleasure were bad then the fault would lay with God, not us. In a truly strange example Abelard describes a monk, dragged in chains, and forced to have sex with women. Abelard’s monk is drawn by the softness of the bed and the touch of the women into pleasure but not consent. “Who” Abelard writes “can venture to call this pleasure nature has made necessary a sin?” (Spade, 1995: §42)

That the behavior is voluntary (d) is also not a defining characteristic of immoral behavior. This is the point at which Abelard disagrees with many other ethical theorists. Abelard not only believes in involuntary consent but also that we are morally responsible for involuntary consent. As Abelard sees it, much immoral behavior is at a fundamental level irrational and thus not voluntary. When an agent consents to commit adultery he consents to the act without wanting the punishment that necessarily follows. He wants his partner to be unmarried, or he wants the sixth commandment to be repealed. Acting in the hope that the moral laws of the universe will alter and allow an exception, just this once, is irrational. The agent’s consent cannot be fully voluntary because he is consenting to something he knows cannot occur. Abelard argues further that a conflict between first and second order desires makes some behavior involuntary. An alcoholic may have a very strong first order desire to drink. This same alcoholic also has a very strong second order desire, namely, the desire not to desire alcohol. The alcoholic desperately wants a drink; he also desperately wants to be free from this desire for alcohol. When this alcoholic drinks alcohol the behavior is involuntary. He consents to drink. He knows what he is doing and he does it. Even though an agent is deeply confused he can still form an intention and consent to it. Abelard writes that such an agent is “compelled to want what he does not want to want. I don’t see how this consent, that we do not want, can be called voluntary.” (Spade, 1995: §33) Abelard nonetheless still considers it consent. If this account is correct, much immoral behavior will be involuntary but still something for which we are morally responsible.

Finally, Abelard argues that the act itself is morally irrelevant. Several of Abelard’s arguments are reiterations of standard themes. He gives the Platonist/Augustinian claim that the act is irrelevant because nothing outside the soul could possibly harm the soul. He also voices a common enough mediaeval claim that all external events occur either by God’s will or at God’s sufferance, thus all external events are in some way good. He points out that we often act in ignorance. In what may be the first serious use of this defense, Abelard argues that if a man genuinely mistakes another woman for his wife he may physically act but he has not sinned because he did not consent to commit adultery. Conversely, a man who arranges to commit adultery and would follow through has committed adultery even if the woman does not show up.

More significant is Abelard’s argument that external acts may be morally indistinguishable. Acts of “charity” can be done for many reasons other than love. The genuine misanthrope who donates to famine relief believing that death is the end of all pain and intending to increase the sum total of human misery does what is good but is not a good person. Strikingly, Abelard argues that the central event in Christian history, the crucifixion of Christ, was carried out by many agents, some praiseworthy for their participation, some not. Christ is to be praised; his consent to suffer crucifixion was morally right. He intended to do what was pleasing to God by redeeming mankind. Judas played an integral role also, but his consent to betray a man he believed to be the messiah was immoral. Even though his action was a necessary part of God’s plan, Judas acted out of some combination of greed and fear, not out of loving obedience to God’s plan. The Jews were morally blameless. The Jews believed that executing this convicted criminal was required by God. They were acting in accordance to what they believed to be God’s will; to have done otherwise would have been a sin. The event of the Crucifixion was brought about by all these agents acting together. Jesus merits moral praise. He consented to what he believed was pleasing to God and his belief was correct. Judas is morally bad. He consented to what he believed was offensive to God. The Jews are blameless, but not morally good. They consented to what they believed was pleasing to God, but their belief was mistaken. The Jews sinned in act but not in fault: it is worse to sin in fault.

The basic question, “What does it mean to be a good person?”, is still unanswered. To be good one must avoid not only sinning in fault but also sinning in action. One must intend to do what one believes shows love of God and neighbor, and these beliefs must be correct. Presumably Abelard would have offered a fuller account in book II of the Ethics or in the unfinished judgment of the Dialogue. His explanation likely would have relied heavily on his discussion of natural law. Through study of the natural law we can recognize goodness and love without divine revelation. There are precepts of natural law that we can discover and probably ought to know. Abelard discusses several examples to show that one can sin in action (violate the natural law) but not in fault (intentionally violate the natural law). Ignorance of these precepts may exonerate us from fault, but the existence of such precepts also means that there is an objective standard we must achieve in order to be morally good. Merely believing our intentions are good is not enough.

The Dialogue between a Philosopher, a Jew, and a Christian is really a pair of dialogues, the first between a Philosopher and a Jew, the second between a Christian and a Philosopher. The fictional circumstance is that a Philosopher (identified as a son of Ishmael and so likely a secular Arab, a notable choice some 35 years after the first crusade), a Jew, and a Christian are arguing over the nature of humanity’s ultimate happiness, and the path to this ultimate happiness. Unable to reach a conclusion, the three come to Abelard begging him to act as judge. Abelard’s judgment is missing.

In the dialogue between the Philosopher and the Jew, the Jew claims that the law of the Old Testament is the path to ultimate human happiness. The Jewish conception of the path to ultimate happiness is characterized as an exhaustive list of prescribed ritual and prohibited behavior. For many of the reasons discussed above, the philosopher argues that it is possible to obey all the precepts of the old law and yet intend to scorn and hate God. Explicit behavior is not necessarily reflective of the inner state of one’s soul. The philosopher argues in turn that true happiness must be within our power to acquire and maintain. Since the only thing we have complete control over is our own soul, the basis for happiness must be internal and in our power to attain.

In the dialogue between the Philosopher and the Christian, the Philosopher defends the Stoic claim that ultimate happiness is the state of mental tranquility achieved when one has attained virtue. For the Philosopher, ultimate happiness is achievable in this life by the person who seeks virtue. The Christian argues that ultimate happiness is attainable only in the afterlife, and that it is different from any state attainable without divine grace. The Christian argues for a sort of beatific vision of God, in which those who love God are rewarded with a clear vision of God that inspires more love and hence clearer vision in an ever rising spiral of pure love and spiritual bliss. (Exactly the opposite happens to those who do not love God. They end up in an ever plummeting spiral of hate and loathing. They also suffer some spiritual equivalent of physical pain: the Christian in the dialogue is concerned that a sinner who does not love God may not subjectively suffer from the alienation from God’s love.) The Philosopher is convinced by the Christian’s arguments. Abelard’s judgment is missing but his own view is likely a combination of these two positions, a Christianizing of Stoicism. Seeking and developing virtue is the path to human happiness, but true happiness is not attainable by human means alone. We need grace. Since human virtue requires that we understand and demonstrate love in this life we are primed to receive and accept this grace. True happiness is then the spiritual bliss and tranquility that comes with the ever rising love and understanding of God. Although without the conclusion to the Dialogue it is impossible to know how Abelard would have worked out many of the details.

7. References and Further Reading

a. General Surveys of Abelard’s Philosophical Works

Any one of the following is an excellent place to look for fuller account of Abelard’s thought. Each of these sources also contains a complete list of Abelard’s works in Latin editions.

  • Brower, J., Guilfoy, K. The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • Marenbon, J. The Philosophy of Peter Abelard. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997).
  • Marenbon, J. “The Rediscovery of Peter Abelard’s Philosophy”. Journal of the History of Philosophy 44.3 (2006) 331-351.
  • Mews, C. Abelard and Heloise. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005).

b. Life

  • Abelard, P. Historia calamitatum. B. Radice (trans.), The Letters of Abelard and Heloise. (London: Penguin, 1974).
  • Clanchy, M. T. Abelard: A Medieval Life. (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 1997).
  • Mews, C. Peter Abelard. Authors of the Middle Ages: historical and religious writers of the Latin West. (Aldershot, Hants.: Variorum, 1995).

c. Universals

  • Abelard, P. Logica Ingredientibus commentary of Porphyry’s Isagoge. P Spade (trans.), Five Texts on the Medieval Problem of Universals: Porphyry, Boethius, Abelard, Duns Scotus, Ockham. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1994).
  • King, P. Peter Abailard and the Problem of Universals in the Twelfth Century. (Ph.D. Diss. Princeton University, 1982).
  • Tweedale, M. M. Abailard on Universals. (Amsterdam: North-Holland, 1976).

d. Logic, Metaphysics, and Philosophy of Mind

There is much scholarly dispute as to how far Abelard intended to take his reductive project in metaphysics, as well as debate about how successful he ultimately was. King 2004 presents Abelard as an extreme “irrealist” about everything except individuals. Marenbon 1997 and 2005 argues for a more moderate reductivism, arguing that there are several items Abelard could not eliminate from his ontology and suggesting it would have been unwise to have tried. Tweedale 1976 describes a category of “non-things” in Abelard’s ontology. These are items that exist but are not individuals. Arlig 2005 draws a distinction between particulars and individuals arguing that everything that exists is particular, that is discrete from everything else, but not everything is an individual.

  • Abelard, P. Logica Ingredientibus commentary on De Interpretatione. Selections on mind and language translated in King 1982: vol ii.
  • Abelard, P. Logica Nostrorum Petitoni Sociorum. Selections on genera and differentia translated in King 1982 vol ii.
  • Abelard, P. Tractatus de Intellectibus (= A Treatise on Understandings). Translated in King 1982, vol ii.
  • Arlig, A. A Study in Early Medieval Mereology: Boethius, Abelard, and Pseudo-Joscelin. (Ph.D. Diss. Ohio State University, 2005).
  • Guilfoy, K. “Mind and Cognition.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • Jacobi, K. “Philosophy of Language” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • King, P. “Metaphysics.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • Kretzmann, N. “The culmination of the old logic in Peter Abelard.” In Renaissance and Renewal in the Twelfth Century, Eds. R. L. Benson and G. Constable, 488–511. (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1982).
  • Martin C. “Logic.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).

e. Ethics

  • Abelard, P. Dialogue between a Philosopher, a Jew, and a Christian (or Collationes). Orlandi, G. and J. Marenbon (trans). Peter Abelard: Collationes. Oxford medieval texts. (Oxford: Clarendon 2001) also translated in Spade 1995.
  • Abelard, P. Ethics (or Scitote Ipsum). trans Spade P. Peter Abelard, Ethical Writings: His Ethics or “Know Yourself” and his Dialogue between a Philosopher, a Jew, and a Christian. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1995).
  • Mann, W. “Ethics.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • Williams, T. “Sin Grace and Redemption.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).

f. William of Champeaux

William’s works are not easily accessible. In many cases all that is easily found are excerpts of unedited manuscripts quoted in other sources. Guilfoy 2005 contains a full list of sources for William’s writings. Citations for works cited in this article are provided here.

  • Guilfoy, K. “William of Champeaux.” in Zalta E. The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2005 Edition).
  • Iwakuma, Y. “Pierre Abélard et Guillaume de Champeaux dans les premières années du XIIe siècle: Une étude préliminaire,” in Langage, sciences, philosophie au XIIe siècle. Ed. J. Baird. Paris: Vrin, 1999.
  • Marenbon, J. “Life Milieu, and Intellectual Contexts.” In The Cambridge Companion to Peter Abelard. Ed. J. Brower and K. Guilfoy. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004).
  • William of Champeaux. Sententiae, ed. Lottin, O. Psychologie et Morale au XIIe et XIIIe siècles. vol v, (Gembloux: Duculot, 1959).

Author Information

Kevin Guilfoy
Email: kguilfoy@carrollu.edu
Carroll College
U. S. A.

Minucius Felix (c. 2nd and 3rd cn. C.E.)

Minucius Felix was a Roman advocate, rhetorician, and Christian apologist. Like Lactantius, Minucius was a convert to Christianity. His only known work, the dialogue Octavius, is one of the earliest examples of Latin apologetics; it is an attack upon paganism and skepticism, and a defense of early Christianity as it was known in the Roman world. Minucius is of interest not only to theologians and Church historians, but also to those with an interest in philosophy and rhetoric. Unlike other Latin apologists of the period, such as Tertullian, who asserted credo quia ineptum (I believe because [it is] absurd) (De Carne Christi 5.4), and who was openly hostile to speculative philosophy, Minucius attempted to establish at least the rational possibility of the Christian faith. The rhetoric found within the Octavius can be considered Ciceronian, having elements of the six-part speech (exordium, narration, partition, confirmation, refutation, and conclusion). This text represents an important stage in the evolution of rhetoric from a primarily oral, forensic, and political art, to a literary art.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Circumstance
  2. The Dialogue
    1. Questions Concerning the Text
    2. The Debate
  3. Conclusion
  4. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Circumstance

Minucius lived in the late 2nd and early 3rd centuries C.E., although the exact dates of his birth and death are unknown. Most of what we know about him comes from his only surviving work, the Octavius. His first name is revealed as Marcus (III.1), and as a Roman advocate, he would “undertake the defense and protection of cases of sacrilege or incest or even murders” (XXVIII.3) within the basilica. He was once a pagan, and “after careful experience of either way of life,” had “repudiated the one and approved of the other” (V.1).

Other sources for his life include Lactantius (240-320), the Professor of Latin Rhetoric at Nicomedia, who writes of Minucius, “among those who are known to me, Minucius Felix was not of mean repute among the case-pleaders of the place. His book, which has the title of Octavius, shows how suitable a defender of truth he could have been if he had devoted himself entirely to that pursuit” (Div. Inst. V.I). St. Jerome (342-420) mentions the Octavius briefly in the De Viris Illustribus and adds that Minucius also wrote a De fato (the fate), although this text has never been found. According to Jerome, Minucius practiced his profession in Rome (LVIII). Many historians assume that he was originally of African origin; his name is found on a dedication at Carthage, and on a column at Tebessa (DeLabriolle 110). However, other men shared his name, so it is unclear if these inscriptions actually refer to the author of the Octavius. In his dialogue, Minucius displays an antipathy towards the Roman policy of expansion: “all that the Romans hold, occupy, and possess is the spoil of outrage” (XXV.5), which may suggest he came to Rome from the provinces, but this could simply be a rhetorical commonplace. Curiously, there is no mention of Minucius in Eusebius’ (260-340) History of the Church, although there are many passages in this tome regarding his contemporary Tertullian (c. 160-230).

From the dialogue, we can gather that Minucius was a highly educated man, with an intimate understanding of ancient authors such as Virgil, Ovid, Nepos, Thallus and Diodorus. His comments on these ancient authors allow historians to consider him a doxographer, or one who enumerates and comments upon texts from earlier periods. His rhetorical Latin is “grand” (gravis) and refined, and his descriptions vivid and compelling. He is careful to avoid slipping into the swollen or drifting style argued against in the Rhetorica ad Herrenium (see book IV). Aside from his religion, there is evidence from the dialogue that Minucius may have been a Stoic prior to his conversion. His passages on the “divine mind,” or the intelligence behind all creation, attest to this (XIX.9-10) (see below).

The Octavius can be understood as an attack against the skepticism of the New Academy and of Pyrrhonism, and an attempt to reconcile nascent Christianity with Stoic philosophy and Roman civic life. But while Minucius rejects skepticism and embraces Stoicism, on first inspection he seems to adhere to the opinion of Tertullian;

What indeed has Athens to do with Jerusalem? What concord is there between the Academy and the Church? What between heretics and Christians? Our instruction comes from the “porch of Solomon” who had himself taught that “the Lord should be sought in simplicity of heart.” Away with all attempts to produce a mottled Christianity of Stoic, Platonic, and dialectic composition! We want no curious disputation after possessing Christ Jesus, no inquisition after enjoying the Gospel (De praescriptione haereticorum 7).

In defending the intellect, Minucius is careful not to assert the primacy of philosophy, for that would be to declare reason above revelation. In this way, he is a member of what Etienne Gilson calls the “Tertullian Family”; he stresses the limitations of the intellect, but not the negation of it (History 48). The Octavius may have been intended to persuade intellectual Romans to reject both paganism and skepticism, and to embrace the new religion. Unlike Tertullian’s dogmatic treatises, the dialogue is an elegant balancing act, careful to stress the fundamental precepts of Christianity, while expressing the practical and ethical value of Stoicism and criticizing the excesses of speculative philosophy. It has been said that Minucius Felix was the only Anti-Nicene father to present both the Christian and pagan side of the question (History 46).

2. The Dialogue

a. Questions Concerning the Text

Modern translations of the Octavius come from a 9th century manuscript in the Biblioteque Nationale in Paris which contains the seven books of Arnobius’ (284-305) Adversus Nationes along with an 8th book—the Octavius. For centuries, scholars have attempted to assign a firm date of composition to the dialogue. The central question has always been, is the Octavius anterior to the Apologeticus of Tertullian? Stylistically, Minucius’ Latin is closer to the classical Latin of Tacitus (54-117) than the excursive Latin of Tertullian, with its “complexity and strangeness” and “unnatural combinations of word and syntax” (Glover 12). Tertullian’s Apologeticus displays a proliferation of compound-complex sentences, intervening phrases and clauses, and awkward constructions. Take for example XXXVIII.4: Aeque spectaculus vestris in tantum renuntiamus in quantum originibus eorum, quas scimus de superstitione conceptas, cum et ipsis rebus, de quibus transiguntur, praetersumus. (Your public games, we renounce too, as heartily as we do their origins; we know these origins lie in superstition; we leave on one side matters with which they are concerned). Minucius’ style is generally more declarative and straightforward, and it is similar to other African writers of the period, such as Frontonius, Flaurus, and Apuleius (DeLabriolle 110).

Unlike the Apologeticus, which takes the form of a protest directed at the magistrates of the Roman Empire, the Octavius is a dialogue featuring individuals whom historians believe may have actually lived in the empire. This use of a dialogue is a Ciceronian technique (although certainly not exclusive to Cicero), and can be seen in De Oratore. Among Christian writers of the period, the dialogue form can also be seen in Ariston of Pella, Justin Martyr, and Caius of Rome (DeLabriolle 127). The Octavius is stylistically closer to the works of previous generations; it is markedly different than the texts written by Christian apologists in the 2nd and 3rd centuries. Nevertheless, the question of style is still debated among historians of Latin and scholars of early apologetics. Among the scholars that argue for the priority of the Octavius is O. Bardenhewer who writes, “It is Tertullian who made use of Minucius, and not Minucius who used the writings of Tertullian” (71).

A clue to the date of the dialogue may be found within Minucius’ statement “if you think of earthly dominions, which surely have analogies to heaven. When has joint monarchy ever started in good faith, or ended without bloodshed?” (XVIII.6). This is perhaps a subtle allusion to the quarrel between the Antonine emperors Caracalla (188-217) and his brother Publius Septimius Geta (189-211), who ruled jointly before the Caracalla assassinated his brother in a fit of rage. The death of Geta was a shocking incident in the history of Rome, and it was surely on the mind of anyone writing during the period. Tertullian’s Scorpiace written in 213 uses the allusion of Cain and Abel to illustrate the significance of this imperial fratricide. Minucius could not risk referring to the event directly, he had to instead use the illustration of the perils of joint rule as a rhetorical commonplace.

Perhaps the strongest argument for the priority of the Apologeticus can be found in Tertullian’s assertion, “[I]f it comes to this that men who were called Romans are found to be enemies, why are we, who are thought to be enemies, denied the name of Romans?” (XXXVI.1). In 212, the Emperor Caracalla passed an edict known as the Constitutio Antoniniana, granting universal citizenship to all free Romans within the many provinces of the Empire. Prior to this, only men living within the Italian peninsula were considered citizens. Ostensibly, the edict’s goal was to extend the benefits of citizenship to all qualified individuals, but it also had the effect of increasing tax revenues and military conscription. The edict is important in that while Tertullian complains of Christians lacking citizenship (at least those within the African provinces), Minucius ignores the issue altogether. Perhaps this is because the citizenship issue had already been settled by the time Minucius resolved to write his dialogue. So while the Octavius appears to be stylistically older than the Apologeticus, it is quite possible that it was composed no earlier than 212, following both the death of Geta, and the enactment of the Constitutio Antoniniana.

St. Cyprian’s Quod idola non dii sint (that idols are not gods), written around 257-8, draws from the Octavius; an obvious parallel can be seen in chapter 9 of Cyprian’s work in which the author declares, “this One cannot be seen, He is too bright to see; cannot be comprehended, He is too pure to grasp” (356), and in the Octavius, “God cannot be seen—he is too bright for sight; nor measured—for he is beyond all sense, infinite, measureless, his dimensions known to himself alone” (XVIII.7). A more telling approximation can be found in the passages of the idola in which Cyprian asserts that the gods of the Romans are merely deified men of antiquity, “Romulus was made a god when Proculus committed perjury” (351). And in a passage from the Octavius, Minucius writes,

It is a waste of time to go through all one by one, and to trace the whole family line; the mortality which we have proved in the case of their first parents has descended to the rest by order of succession. But perhaps you [Caecilius] imagine that men become gods after death; Romulus was made a god by the false oath of Proculus (XXI.9).

Since Lactantius mentions Minucius, and Cyprian used the Octavius as a source for the idola, the text must be no later than the middle of the 3rd century. Conversely, most scholars assume that the Apologeticus was composed in 197. Another possibility is that both the Octavius and the Apologeticus draw from an earlier text that has been lost, but this hypothesis has never been proven.

Some histories of rhetoric maintain that Minucius used the Apologeticus as a template, but the differences between the texts counterbalance the similarities. Tertullian’s work can be classified under the blanket appellation literary rhetoric; his letters were usually intended for a single reader, oftentimes a Roman political leader such as Scapula (proconsul of Africa) or a theological adversary such as Praxeas. These works were not forensic exercises or speeches intended for large audiences; they were never intended to be performed. In the case of the Apologeticus we must consider that the advent of Christianity into the Roman Empire placed new obligations and prerogatives upon the rhetorician. As George Kennedy points out, “[e]xercises in declamation often lost touch with contemporary realities, a fact lamented by Quintilian, Tacitus, and others” (129). The new religion was one such “contemporary reality,” and it required, for its defense the evolving art of apologetics, first seen in Justin Martyr’s (100-165) Dialogue With Trypho the Jew. Nevertheless, apologetics depends greatly upon rhetoric, and Christians were obligated to learn the art, even though Tertullian forbade them from ever teaching it (On Idolatry 10).

So if we conclude that the texts are contra-distinct, the central question concerns the type or genre of oratory the Octavius represents. It is not an argument directed at a Roman official, or even a work intended to encourage persecuted Christians (exhortation). It contains elements of apologetics, yet retains more of a classical rhetorical structure; it stands somewhere between Cicero and Tertullian in form. Within the dialogue is a forensic debate in which Octavius Januarius defends his faith against the prosecutor Caecilius, with Minucius acting as arbiter. Arbesmann and others suggest that this debate is in the form of a controversia (317), a rhetorical exercise popular in the first century. In this exercise (described by Seneca the Elder), the instructor creates a special case for his students to build their arguments around. The teacher may posit a dilemma in which application of a particular law is difficult due to the circumstances involved; for instance, a woman who is raped has the choice of ordering the execution of her assailant or marrying him. But then it is discovered that the same man has raped two women in one night; one demands his death, the other asks him to marry her. For the Octavius to be a controversia it would have to be both fictional and hypothetical, however there is no evidence that it is either. Because there is a central issue (the “error” of paganism as opposed to the “truth” of Christian revelation), the dialogue can be considered an apology with a kind of scholastic dialectic which dictates its form, a pro et contra. All such dialectics have a deliberative character. Caecilius acts as the spokesman for the traditional Roman religion, and Octavius performs the same function for Christianity. The arguments follow and a conclusion is ultimately reached.

So while the text has forensic (judicial) characteristics, its genre can be considered deliberative in the Ciceronian sense, as the issue of expediency is central; should the honorable Roman continue to follow “the thick darkness of vulgar ignorance,” risking a wreck upon “stones, however carved and anointed and garlanded they may be,” i.e. the pagan tradition with its many eloquent champions, or should he turn to the “broad daylight” (II.1) of the new religion? The Octavius is an argument intended for Roman ears, not Christian, and as Cicero remarks, in any deliberative endeavor, the orator must know “the character of the community” (De Oratore II.337). As Gilson points out, Octavius avoids the “blunt dogmatism of Christian faith, something unpalatable to the cultured pagan mind” (46). This partially explains the curious absence of Christology within the text; the birth, death, and resurrection of Jesus are not mentioned. As DeLabriolle indicates, “amongst the apologists of the IInd century, Aristides, St. Justin and Tertullian are the only ones who have uttered the name of Jesus Christ” (117). Despite this, some have suggested that Minucius is somehow more orthodox than Tertullian, since the latter ultimately fell in with the Montanists (Forster 260). But his orthodoxy cannot be attested to, since he is intentionally vague on specific doctrinal matters. It would be counterproductive to swamp potential converts with the esoteric aspects of Christianity at the outset; Minucius instead presents and defends the exoteric image of the church. And while drawing heavily from ancient authors and historical events, Minucius never once uses scripture as an illustration of a point or concept.

b. The Debate

The dialogue opens with Minucius’ recollections of his friendship to the recently deceased Octavius. The dead man was the “sole confident” of his affections, and his “partner in wanderings from the truth” (I.4-5). The language and circumstance is almost identical to that of Cicero in book 3 of De Oratore, as Cicero describes his “bitter recollection” that has “revived old feelings of distress and grief in [his] heart,” (III.1-2) when he contemplates the death of fellow intellectual Lucius Crassus. In both instances, the occasion brings forth an opportunity to launch into a deliberative dialogue. As in Plato’s Phaedrus, the debate takes place in the countryside, away from the noise and distraction of urban life. The setting is Ostia, a pleasant resort town less than twenty miles from Rome, known for its baths. Minucius, Octavius Januarius, and Caecilius have come to the resort to obtain “relief from judicial duties” (II.3). While walking along the shore, the men encounter an image of Serapsis, a Graeco-Egyptian god. Caecilius blows a kiss to the god, which is immediately followed by Octavius’ chastisement of Minucius, that no man has the right to leave his friend in the “thick darkness of vulgar ignorance” (III.1). It is Octavius’ position that any honorable Roman has the obligation to encourage his friends to accept the truth of Christianity.

An interesting section follows, in which the men proceed down the beach and see a group of boys skipping rocks in the ocean. It is a contest in which the boy who wins is the one whose shard travels the farthest out into the sea, and it is perhaps a metaphor for the power of argument within the contest of rhetoric. The scene awakens within Caecilius the desire to answer Octavius’ indirect accusation. He suggests a debate in which Minucius is to act as arbiter, and as a guarantee of Minucius’ impartiality, Caecilius commands him to “take your seat as a novice, ignorant as it were of either side of the case” (V.1-2).

Caecilius’ prooemium is direct and forthright; he believes he is defending that which is honorable (not only the Roman religion, but the philosophy of Skepticism), and makes no attempt at winning the audience’s favor. This is consistent with book one of the Rhetorica ad Herrenium, in which a direct opening (prooemium) should be used instead of a subtle opening (ephodos) if the speaker’s (or writer’s) cause is honorable and his position confident (I.IV.5-8). A closer analysis of his opening reveals that his Latin is “rounded,” as the critical concept (informandus est animus) is carried structurally in the middle, and subordinate ideas are handled with adversative, causal, and relative clauses (O’Connor 167). It is a stylistic pattern that will be repeated throughout his speech. Caecilius declares that everyone “must feel indignant and annoyed that certain persons—persons untrained in study, uninitiated in letters … should come to fixed conclusions upon the universe” (V.4). The ad hominem charge that Christians, traditionally members of the Roman lower classes, and with little education, are in no position to assert their position on theological matters is not original; it can be seen in Tertullian’s Apologeticus as well. Caecilius follows this with the statement: Sufficient be it for our happiness, and sufficient for our wisdom if, according to the ancient oracle of the wise men, we learn closer acquaintance with our own selves. But seeing that with mad and fruitless toil we overstep the limits of our humble intelligence, and from our earth-bound level seek, with audacious eagerness, to scale heaven itself and the stars of heaven, let us at least not aggravate our error by vain and terrifying imaginations (V.5-6).

This passage is important on a number of levels: the reference to the Oracle of Delphi and the ancient maxim “know thyself,” display Caecilius’ sympathy for the “New Academy,” the movement of Platonic philosophy into the regions of skepticism. This also sounds very similar to the passage in De Natura Deorum, “[a]nd until this issue is decided, mankind must continue to labor under the profoundest uncertainty, and to be in ignorance about matters of the highest moment” (I.3).

Caecilius continues his speech with a particularly poetic and vivid illustration of the fortuitous and capricious nature of the physical world; natural disasters destroy the innocent as well as the guilty, and the harvest is obliterated by violent squalls and suffocating droughts. If divine intelligence and wisdom ruled the world, we would not see so much injustice in the human realm. Camillus would not have been sent into exile, Socrates would never have been forced to drink hemlock, and the tyrants Phalaris and Dionysius “would never have deserved a throne” (V.12). The proposition or partitio is then introduced, “[C]um igitur aut fortuna caeca aut incerta natura sit“, and the Latin here is a little unclear; it should probably read, “[S]eeing then that either blind fortune or uncertain nature” are the two possibilities open to us, we should “accept the teaching of our elders as the priest of truth” (VI.1). Caecilius feels “since everything evades man’s grasp, he ought to cling with all the more tenacious energy to those fixed points which are open to him” (DeLabriolle 112). The Romans can judge their efforts at piety simply by the results given to them: Rome has enjoyed hundreds of years of prosperity and expansion under the pagan gods, even as it has absorbed other religions and deities from people like the Gauls, Syrians, and Taurians. Military leaders have seen their successes and failures depend upon the favor of the gods; Brennus was defeated at the river Allia in 390 B.C. because of his “contempt for the auspices” (VII.4). Marcus Crassus dared to attack the Parthians after ignoring the imprecations of the Furies (VIII.5), and was summarily routed. Even those that have claimed the supremacy of their god over the Roman pantheon, the Jews for instance, have ended up in captivity to Rome. As Gilson remarks, “had not these gods led to world leadership? No doctrine could be certain enough to justify national apostasy” (History 46). Within this section, Caecilius uses rhetorical techniques such as preterition and paralipsis to emphasize that he argues from common sense and communal knowledge; “[M]ulta praetereo consulto” (Much I purposely pass over) (X.1), “[s]ed omitto communia (things however common to all I pass over) (XII.2), and finally, “[m]ulta ad haec subpetunt, ni festinat oratio” (much might be added on this subject) (XI.5).

Caecilius then turns his attention towards specific tenets of the Christian religion. What if the body has gone to pieces? Will it be resurrected this way? When Christians suffer in pyres or on crosses, why does their god refuse to help them? Their god cannot attend to particulars because he is preoccupied with the whole, and cannot attend to the whole because he is preoccupied with particulars (X.5). If the Christians dare to philosophize, they would do well to follow the maxim of Socrates, “that which is above us does not concern us,” an attitude from which “flowed the guarded skepticism of Arcesilas, and later of Carneades” (XIII.1-3). Arcesilas was one of the first philosophers to teach the suspension of judgment (epokhé) that leads to ataraxía (freedom from worry). This philosophy would be expanded by Sextus Empiricus in the late 3rd century in his Outlines of Pyrrhonism (see below).

In his conclusion, Caecilius returns to the central argument of his speech, that “things that are doubtful, as they are, should be left in doubt” (XIV.5). DeLabriolle describes Caecilius as ” an admirable representative of those lettered pagans who were very skeptical as regards the foundation of things, but who from civic pietas and from respect for the mos majorum, thought it their duty to energetically defend the religion of tradition” (113). When Caecilius begins to brag and insult Octavius, Minucius intervenes and tells him it is truth (veritati), not glory (laudi) they are striving for (XIV.3). This is further evidence of the deliberative nature of the dialogue; it is not a forensic contest or a flowery debate, but a search for truth. In any debate, one can dazzle an audience with a virtuosic display and thus win honors for himself, and some have argued that this became the principle interest of orators during the Imperial age (Dunn 4). But Minucius obviously expects more from rhetoric. He furthers his criticism of the art by saying, “an audience, as everyone knows , is so easily swayed. Fascination of words distracts them from attention to facts … forgetting that the incredible contains an element of truth, and probability an element of falsehood” (XIV.4). This at once sets the stage for a new philosophy, one that eschews Skepticism, and it serves as a transition and introduction to the speech of Octavius. It is he who will stress the incredible as true.

After declaring the need to take the verity of all arguments into consideration, Minucius then moves beyond criticism of rhetoric to comment on Skepticism directly, “[a]ccordingly we must take good care not to become victims of a dislike of all arguments whatsoever” (XIV). We cannot take the position of the Pyrrhonists and say:

while the dogmatizer posits the matter of his dogma as substantial truth, the skeptic enunciates his formulae so that they are virtually cancelled by themselves, he should not be said to dogmatize his enunciation of them. And most important of all, in his enunciation of these formulae he states what appears to himself and announces his own impression in an undogmatic way, without making any positive assertion regarding the external realities (Outlines 14-15).

According to the Pyrrhonists, only the dogmatist asserts the absolute “truth” of any given proposition, the skeptic merely enunciates what he sees. Minucius feels that to abstain from asserting anything either positive or negative is to display a contempt for argument, and therefore a contempt for truth. One who does not believe in truth cannot take revelation seriously, and this attitude thus undermines the very foundations of Christianity. But this goes beyond religion, as Sextus Empiricus includes the Epicureans and Stoics among the “dogmatists” he rejects (3). If we accept that Pyrrhonism represents the evolution of Skepticism from the New Academy of Carneades (214-129 B.C.) to a new “Roman” equivalent, in that they find a common bond in the primacy of akatalêpsia (also see Hakinson 50) and ataraxía, we can see the underlying conflict in the Octavius transcends religious issues. How can the Roman advocate argue from a position of logos (reason) if everything is uncertain? How can the Stoic or Epicurean extol the virtues of his philosophy if equally persuasive arguments exist to the contrary? How can anyone be certain that what he or she learns is of value?

Caecilius immediately objects to Minucius’ interference, accusing him of attempting to “break the force of [his] pleading by interpolating this weighty subject for debate; it is for Octavius to deal with my several points” (XV.1). Octavius finally responds with his exordium, by doing two things: to speak of himself to win the audience’s sympathy, and to speak of his adversary. He requests the assistance of the audience to “turn the floodgates of truth upon the stains of blackening calumny” (XVI.1). As in an enthymeme, the orator must supply the necessary premises and the audience must reach the intended conclusion. According to Octavius, Caecilius is a man “who does not know the right way, when the road happens to fork off in several directions; and not knowing the way, he doubts and hesitates” (XVI.3). Such a man does not know the implications of such a vacillating world-view. He accuses Caecilius of declaring that the gods cannot be said to exist one moment, and then insisting that they must be worshipped the next.

Octavius then offers his own partitio, “I will refute and disprove his inconsistent arguments by proving and establishing a single truth; setting him free from all further occasion for doubt and wandering” (XVI.4). What follows is a direct appeal to the Roman ideal of expediency and practical wisdom in the form of an argument by analogy, “without careful investigation of the nature of deity, you cannot know that of man; just as you cannot manage the civic affairs successfully without some knowledge of the wider world-society of men” (XVII.2). There is a relationship between theology and humanity, a relationship that must be understood by anyone attempting wise governance of mankind.

The first point Octavius tackles is that of intelligent design, or the divine intention behind creation. The regularity in the motion of the heavens, the waxing and waning moon, the blooming of flowers, all of these things attest to God’s involvement in nature. There is a similar passage in Cicero’s De Natura Deorum:

There are however other philosophers, and those of eminence and note, who believe that the whole world is ruled and governed by divine intelligence and reason … the weather and the seasons and the changes of the atmosphere by which all products of the soil are ripened and matured are the gift of the immortal gods to the human race (I.4-5).

But of greater importance, is Cicero’s adumbration that Carneades argued against this position persuasively, and this brings us back to the argument between Caecilius and Octavius.

Octavius proceeds from an enumeration of the products of the divine intelligence to the nature of God himself. His statements “God cannot be seen—he is too bright for sight; nor measured—for he is beyond all sense, infinite, measureless, his dimensions known to himself alone” (XVIII.7), and “the majesty of God is the despair of the understanding” (XIX.14) foreshadow negative theology of the Arians and Cappadocians. Gregory of Nyssa (d.385), for instance, claimed that because time implies measurement, God is therefore “out of time … and the deity is of course incommensurable” (Mortley 129). This via negativa (negative way) would later find its fullest expression in the works of 5th century theologian Dionysius the Pseudo-Areopagite. Octavius’ admonition “[S]eek not a name for God: God is his name. Terms are needed when individuals have to be distinguished from the mass” (XVIII.10), may find some foundation in certain passages of scripture, such as Exodus 3:14, in which God says to Moses “I am who am,” and Malachi 3:6, “I the Lord change not,” but there are no direct examples of Minucius’ exegesis, so this is only speculation. In his Against Eunomius Gregory takes up the issue of “names” for God. When the theologian says, “God is good,” or “God is immutable,” he introduces a copula between God and another term (Pr.). This “isness of God remains undescribed. The ‘is’ of the copula refers to the being of God, and this is actually undefinable” (Mortley 180). To bolster his argument that God is infinite (and ultimately unknowable in a human sense), Minucius offers the supporting opinions of Xenophanes (who held God to be infinite) and Aristotle (who assigns a single power of intelligence behind creation).

Upon establishing his confirmatio, Minucius then moves into the refutatio. The gods and religious traditions of the Romans are products of an “ignorant tradition, charmed or captivated by its pet fables” (XX.2). And in an amazing bit of inconsistency, asks “[w]hy recall old wives’ tales of human beings changed into birds and beasts, or into trees and flowers? Had such things happened in the past, they would happen now; as they cannot happen now, they did not happen then” (XX.4). Such an argument could easily be used against the Christians.

As to the argument of collective wisdom, Octavius dismisses it as “[g]eneral insanity shield[ing] itself behind the multitude of the insane” (XXIII.10), an insanity promoted by the “fatal influence” of poets. It was right for Plato to exclude Homer from the ideal Republic, for “he above all others in his Iliad, though half in jest, gave gods a place in the affairs and doings of men” (XXIV.2-4). The Romans are vain in thinking such incestuous and fictitious beings somehow hold dominion over the affairs of humanity. And In the next section, Octavius counters Caecilius’ argument that the Christian god is oblivious to the suffering of his subjects. The success of the Jews depended upon their fidelity to the one God; when they deserted Him, they fell into captivity and misery. “That those who know not God deserve their tortures, as impious and unrighteous, none but an atheist doubts” (XXXV.4). And if one dares to say the Christians are a miserable lot, Octavius counters that they would prefer to despise wealth than hoard it, turning to the maxim: “[a]s on the highroad he who walks lightest walks with most ease” (XXXVI.6). The Stoic suffering of the persecuted Christians is evidence of their collective conviction that paradise awaits them following death. And in death, everyone is equal; “[a]re you of noble lineage? Proud of your ancestry? yet we are all born equal; virtue alone gives mark.” What good is it “to shine in purple and be squalid in mind” (XXXVII.10-11). The parallels between this attitude and Stoic philosophy are obvious. As the Emperor Marcus Aurelius (121-180) said in book II of his Meditations, “do the things external which fall upon thee distract thee?”

Octavius closes with a final attack on the philosophers he despises:

Let Socrates look to himself! Socrates, “the buffoon of Athens” (as Zeno called him), who confessed he knew nothing, though he boasted of the promptings of a deceiving demon; Arcesilas too, and Carneades, and Pyrrho, and even the whole host of the Academics, let them argue on! (XXXVIII.5-6).

This passage is as important for the names Octavius leaves off the list, as the names he puts on it. According to Octavius, Skepticism is the bastard child of Socrates, a child that has been nurtured by the New Academy, and is even now asserting its pernicious influence over Roman life. The Christians reject the attitude of these “high-brow” philosophers, as the faithful “do not preach great things, but we live by them” (XXXVIII.6). Philosophy is an idle and vain pursuit if it does not include the truth that comes from revelation, an idea that would characterize many of Tertullian’s theological disputations.

In his final comments, Octavius borrows a page from Caecilius’ handbook, and uses the first person plural to adopt a conciliatory tone, “Fruamur bono nostro et recti sententiam temperemus” (let us enjoy our good things, coordinate our sense of right) (XXXVIII.7).

Upon completion of the second speech, Caecilius declares Octavius to be the winner, but also claims a victory for himself, in that he has had his triumph over error. He understands the main issue to be one of providence, the same issue that is central to book one of Cicero’s De Natura Deorum. The skeptic denies providence, and therefore cannot enjoy the fullness of truth (alétheia).

3. Conclusion

The Octavius stands apart from Tertullian’s Apologeticus in that it is less dogmatic, more consistent with Roman sensibilities, and more eloquently expresses the difficult philosophical problems of the day. Gilson astutely points out, “Tertullian seems to have completely forgotten what reasons he had once had to be pagan. This is something which Minucius has never forgotten” (History 46). The dialogue illustrates many of the problems nascent Christianity faced during the Imperial era. Long before St. Augustine of Hippo (354-430) reconciled his faith with Neo-Platonism, the Latin fathers struggled with defining the boundaries between reason and revelation; Skepticism was always dangerously lurking in the corner. Minucius’ view is clear when he exclaims, “he [Octavius] disarmed ill-will by the very weapons which the philosophers use for their attack, and had set forth truth in a guise at once so easy and so attractive” (XXXIX.7). Rhetoric and logic are not to be discarded when defending the faith, but one must be careful not to assert the sovereignty of these worldly arts over the sublime truths of revelation.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Bardenhewer, Otto. Patrologie. Freiberg: Herder, 1901.
  • Barnes, Timothy David. Tertullian: A Historical and Literary Study. Oxford: Clarendon, 1971.
  • Boyes-Stones, G.R. Post-Hellenistic Philosophy: A Study of its Development From the Stoics to Origen. New York: Oxford, 2001.
  • Cicero, Marcus Tullius. De Natura Deorum & Academica. Trans. H. Rackham. London: Putnam, 1932.
  • Cicero, Marcus Tullius. De Inventione, De Optimo Genere Oratorum, Topica. Trans. H.M. Hubbell. London: William Heinemann LTD, 1968.
  • Cyprianus, Thascius Caecilius. Treatises. Trans. Roy J. Deferrari. New York: Catholic University Press, 1958.
  • DeLabriolle, Pierre. History of Literature of Christianity From Tertullian to Boethius. London: Kegan Paul, Trench, Trubner & Co., 1924.
  • Dunn, Geoffrey D. “Rhetorical Structure in Tertullian’s Ad Scaplam.” Vigilae Christiannae 56 (2002): 47-55.
  • Dunn, Geoffrey D. “Rhetoric and Tertullian’s De Virginibus Velandis.” Vigilae Christiannae 59 (2005): 1-30.
  • Empiricus, Sextus. Outlines of Pyrrhonism. Trans. R.G. Bury. New York: Promethius, 1990.
  • Eusebius. History of the Church From Christ to Constantine. Trans. G.A. Williamson. New York: Dorset, 1984.
  • Felix, Minucius. Octavius. Trans. Gerald H. Rendall. Cambridge: Harvard University, 2003.
  • Felix, Minucius. Octavius. Trans. Arbesmann, Rudolph. Washington, D.C.: Catholic University Press, 1962.
  • Forster, Roger, & Paul Marston. Reason & Faith. Eastbourne: Monarch Publications, 1980.
  • Gilson, Etienne. History of Christian Philosophy in the Middle Ages. London: Sheed & Ward, 1955.
  • Gilson, Etienne. Reason and Revelation in the Middles Ages. New York: Scribners, 1938.
  • Glover, T.R. Life and Letters in the Fourth Century. New York: Russell, 1968.
  • Hackinson, R.J. “Values, Objectivity, and Dialectic; The Skeptical Attack on Ethics: Its Methods, Aims, and Success.” Phronesis 39 (1993): 45-68.
  • Kennedy, George. Classical Rhetoric and Its Christian and Secular Tradition From Ancient to Modern Times. Chapel Hill: North Carolina, 1999.
  • Lactantius. The Divine Institutes. Trans. Sister Mary Francis McDonald. Washington D.C.: Catholic University of America Press, 1964.
  • Marias, Julian. Philosophy as Dramatic Theory. University Park: Penn State, 1971.
  • Mortley, Raoul. From Word to Silence: The Rise and Fall of Logos. Hanstein: Bonn, 1986.
  • O’Connor, Joseph. “The Conflict of Rhetoric in the ‘Octavius’ of Minucius Felix.” Classical Folia 30 (1976): 165-173.
  • Quintilian, Marcus Fabius. Institutio Oratorio. Trans. John Selby. Carbondale: Southern Illinois, 1987.
  • Tertullian, Septimius Florentis. Apologeticus & De Spectaculus. Trans. T.R. Glover. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2003.
  • Tertullian, Septimius Florentis. Adversus Praxean Liber. London: University of Edinburgh, 1948.
  • Tertullian, Septimius Florentis. The Writings of Tertullian II: Ante Nicene Christian Library Translations of the Writings of the Fathers Down to AD 325. Trans. Alexander Roberts.

Author Information

C. Francis Higgins
Email: colin@louisiana.edu
University of Louisiana Lafayette
U. S. A.

Modern Chinese Philosophy

The term “modern Chinese philosophy” is used here to denote various Chinese philosophical trends in the short period between the implementation of the constitutional “new policy” (1901) and the abolition of the traditional examination system (1905) in the late Qing (Ch’ing) dynasty and the rise and fall of the Republic of China in mainland China (1911-1949). As an ancient cultural entity, China seemed to be frozen in a time capsule for thousands of years until it suddenly defrosted as a direct result of military invasions and exploitation by the West and Japan since the Opium War of 1839-42. Thus, one may argue that China had longer “classical” and “medieval” periods than the West, whereas its “modern” period began relatively recently. Modern Chinese philosophy is rooted historically in the traditions of Buddhism, Confucianism, especially Neo-Confucianism, and the Xixue (“Western Learning,” that is, mathematics, natural sciences and Christianity) that arose during the late Ming Dynasty (ca. 1552-1634) and flourished until the early Republic Period (1911-1923). In particular, the Jingxue (School of Classical Studies), or classical Confucianism, developed in the early Qing dynasty, which critiqued Neo-Confucian thought as impractical and subjective and instead championed a pragmatic approach to resolving China’s dilemmas as a nation, exerting a powerful influence on the development of modern Chinese philosophy. Modern Chinese philosophers typically responded to critiques of their heritage by both Chinese and Western thinkers either by transforming Chinese tradition (as in the efforts of Zhang Zhidong and Sun Yat-sen), defending it (as in the work of traditional Buddhists and Confucians), or opposing it altogether (as in the legacy of the May Fourth New Cultural Movement, including both its liberal and its communist exponents). Many modern Chinese philosophers advanced some form of political philosophy that simultaneously promoted Chinese national confidence while problematizing China’s cultural and intellectual traditions. In spite of this, a striking feature of most modern Chinese philosophy is its retrieval of traditional Chinese thought as a resource for addressing 20th century concerns.

Table of Contents

  1. Dividing Chinese Philosophy into Periods
  2. Historical Background
  3. The Transformational Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy
    1. Zhang Zhidong
    2. Sun Yat-sen
    3. Chinese Scholasticism
  4. The Anti-Traditional Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy
    1. Yan Fu and Western Learning
    2. The May Fourth New Cultural Movement
    3. Hu Shi
    4. Chen Duxiu
    5. The Debate of 1923
  5. The Traditional Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy
    1. Yang Rensan and the Buddhist Renaissance
    2. Ou-Yang Jingwu and the Chinese Academy of Buddhism
    3. Liang Shuming and Neo-Confucianism
    4. Fung Yulan and Neo-Confucianism
    5. Carsun Chang and Neo-Confucianism
    6. Xiong Shili and Neo-Confucianism
    7. Wang Kuowei and Classical Confucianism
    8. Thome Fang and Classical Confucianism
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Dividing Chinese Philosophy into Periods

The term “modern Chinese philosophy” is used here to denote various Chinese philosophical trends in the short period between the implementation of the constitutional “new policy” (1901) and the abolition of the traditional examination system (1905) in the late Qing Dynasty and the rise and fall of the Republic of China in mainland China (1911-1949). Admittedly, the term “modern philosophy” often refers to Western philosophy since the 17th century , characterized by the critical and independent spirit inspired by the Scientific Revolution, but there is no counterpart to this movement in 17th-19th century Chinese intellectual history. As an antique, independent cultural entity, China seemed to be frozen in a time capsule for thousands of years until it suddenly defrosted as a direct result of military invasions and exploitation by the West and Japan since the Opium War of 1839-42. Thus, one may argue that China had longer “classical” and “medieval” periods than the West, whereas its “modern” period began relatively recently.

With this demarcation in mind, the history of Chinese philosophy can be divided into five phases: the ancient (ca. 1000 BCE-588 CE), the medieval (589-959 CE), the Renaissance (960-1900 CE), the modern (1901-1949 CE), and the contemporary (after 1949 CE). Roughly speaking, many parallels to the history of Western philosophy can be discerned in this division. Like Greek philosophy, ancient Chinese philosophy was dominated by a spirit of fundamental humanism rather than theistic enthusiasm. Like Christian scholasticism, medieval Chinese philosophy was dominated by a religious concern displayed in the teachings of the multifarious Buddhist schools. The Renaissance of Chinese philosophy may be found in the Neo-Confucian movement that lasted for one thousand years through four dynasties: the Song (960-1279), Yuan (1280-1367), Ming (1368-1643) and Qing (1644-1911). Finally, all schools of modern and contemporary Western thought have prompted modern and contemporary Chinese philosophy to respond to their profound challenges. These various modes of response include the affirmation of tradition, the transformation of tradition, and the abandonment of tradition, once and for all. Collectively, these three modes of response function as the background to the development of modern Chinese philosophy and also help identify three of its major trends: the transformational trend (represented by Zhang Zhidong and Sun Yat-sen), the traditional trend (represented by traditional Buddhism, classical Confucianism, and Neo-Confucianism, respectively), and the anti-traditional trend (represented by the Liberalism and the Communism fostered by the May Fourth New Cultural Movement). While there have been various developments within other minor schools, only the major strains of thought will be treated briefly here.

2. Historical Background

Liang Qichao (1873-1930), a renowned early 20th century Chinese philosopher, suggested in his The Chinese Academic History in the Past Three Hundred Years (Zhongkuo jinsanbainien xueshushi) that modern Chinese philosophy was rooted in the traditions of classical Confucianism, Neo-Confucianism, Pure Land Buddhism, and the Xixue (“Western Learning,” that is, mathematics, natural sciences and Christianity) that arose during the late Ming Dynasty (ca. 1552-1634) and flourished until the early Republic Period (1911-1923). As he noted, there were two Confucian traditions handed down from the Han dynasty (206 BCE-220 CE) to the early Qing dynasty, namely, classical Confucianism (Jingxue) and Neo-Confucianism (Lixue). The so-called Lixue or Daoxue (the learning of reasons or of universal principles), represented in the Song dynasty by Zhu Xi’s Lixue (Rationalism) and Lu Xiangshan’s Xinxue (Idealism) and in the Ming dynasty by Wang Yangming (a follower of Lu), can be regarded as a renaissance of the ideal of humanity within Confucianism, yet it is a syncretic system composed of various elements of Chan (Zen) Buddhism, sectarian Daoism, and Confucianism (mainly based on the Analects, Mencius , Daxue (Great Learning), Zhongyong (Doctrine of the Mean), and the Xicixuan (Conspectus of the Book of Changes), the first four of which Zhu Xi annotated and entitled the Four Books, which became the corpus of Neo-Confucian teaching).

In opposition to the Neo-Confucian approach, there emerged the so-called Jingxue (School of Classics Studies) or classical Confucianism developed in the early Qing dynasty that was founded on the study of the “Six Classics,” that is the Yijing (Book of Changes), the Shujing (Classic of Ancient History), the Shijing (Classic of Poetry), the now-lost Yuejing (Classic of Music), the Lijing (Classic of Propriety), and the Chunqiu (Annals of the Spring and Autumn Period). Liang argued that the major difference between the two is that Neo-Confucianism places great emphasis on abstractions such as xin (mind), xing (human nature), li (reason), and qi (material-force) and demonstrates little concern for practical affairs such as economic, political, and military knowledge that will strengthen the national defense, benefit the public welfare, and promote people’s livelihood. To find a scapegoat for the collapse of the Ming dynasty (the last imperial regime led by ethnic Chinese), many late Ming intellectuals blamed Wang Yangming’s idealism for the ruin of their country. Thus the Jingxue thinkers urged Confucius’ genuine followers to turn to the original Confucian teachings through exegesis, not only of the Four Books, but of the Six Classics, which they supposed to be uncontaminated by Buddhism and Daoism. As they observed, Confucius taught his students with “Six Arts” (ritual, music, archery, horse-riding, calligraphy, and mathematics), which were the basic requirements for a gentleman of the pre-Qin era. These thinkers regarded the “Six Arts” as examples of practical learning and claimed that Confucius never made impractical, soul-seeking meditation or discussions of mind, spirit, and human nature the primal tasks of learning. In contrast to the subjective, idealistic approach applied by Wang Yangming’s school, the Jingxue thinkers promoted what they saw as a more realistic, objective approach to the study of the Classics and the pursuit of practical knowledge of agriculture, public administration, economics, national defense, and so forth. Among them, Ku Yanwu (1613-1682), Yan Yuan (1635-1704), and Dai Zhen (1724-1777) made great contributions to late Ming pragmatism. Their criticisms of Neo-Confucianism are still wielded with some force by those who critique Neo-Confucian thought today.

Another major intellectual trend that had exercised great influence on modern Chinese philosophy was Buddhism, a foreign religion that first came to China in the late Han dynasty. From then onward, Buddhism became popular with ordinary people as a folk belief for its promise to satisfy their secular needs, and gradually became attractive to scholars for the complexity and intricacy of its metaphysical and psychological theories. Imbued with the humanistic teaching of traditional philosophy, Chinese scholars found the Buddhist doctrines of “emptiness” (sunyata) and “non-self” or “self-denial” (wuwo) unacceptable until they were rendered intelligible and transformed in terms of the Daoist doctrines of “non-being” (wu) and “self-abstention” (wuyu), using the philosophical method of geyi (analogous interpretation) produced by the Neo-Daoists of the 3rd to 5th centuries CE. Once thus accepted, the Buddhist doctrines flourished in the Sui (590-617) and Tang (618-906) dynasties, during which four major Chinese Buddhist schools developed: the Huayan (“Flower Garland,” based on the Flower Ornament Sutra]), Tiantai (“Heavenly Platform,” based on the Lotus Sutra), Chan (“Meditation”–better known by its Japanese equivalent, Zen–based on the Vajracchedika Sutra and the Lankavatatra Sutra), and Jingtu (“Pure Land,” based on the Amitayus Sutra). Among these schools of Chinese Buddhism, the greatest tension has existed between Chan, which has maintained an iconoclastic attitude toward traditional Buddhist precepts and scriptural study, and “Pure Land,” whose theistic and ritualistic flavor helped to ensure its widespread popularity beginning in the Ming dynasty.

Finally, all schools of modern Chinese philosophy have submitted themselves to tremendous influence from “Western Learning” or Xixue, which flourished between the late Ming dynasty and the early Qing dynasty through the importation of Western astronomy, geometry, geography, mathematics, and natural sciences along with Christianity by Jesuit missionary scholars such as Matteo Ricci (1552-1610). With the help of Chinese scholars Xu Gunag-chi (1561-1633), Li Zhizao (1565-1630), and others, Ricci translated Euclid’s geometrical text The Elements. His work Shiyi (True Ideas of God ) introduced the scholastic concepts of “being,” “substance,” “essence,” and “existence” with a view to synthesizing the Christian view of the soul with the Confucian theory of human nature. The prospect of “Western Learning” was suddenly squelched by the Qing emperor Yongzheng (r. 1723-1735) on the grounds that the Jesuits were interfering in court politics. “Western Learning” was revived after the Opium War, however, and soon came into vogue among Chinese thinkers who opposed tradition in the name of “modernization.” The result has been most vividly described by Wing-tsit Chan, who writes: “At the turn of the [20th] century, ideas of Schopenhauer, Kant, Nietzsche, Rousseau, Tolstoy, and Kropotkin were imported. After the intellectual renaissance of 1917, the movement advanced at a rapid pace. In the following decade, important works of Descartes, Spinoza, Hume, James, Bergson, and Marx, and others became available in Chinese. Dewey, Russell, and Dreisch came to China to lecture, and special numbers of journals were devoted to Nietzsche and Bergson… Almost every trend of thought had its exponent. James, Bergson, Euken, Whitehead, Hocking, Schiller, T. H. Creen, Carnap, and C. I. Lewis had their own following. For a time it seemed Chinese thought was to be completely Westernized.” (Chan 1963:743)

3. Transformational Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy

a. Zhang Zhidong

From the late 19th century to the first half of the 20th century, China suffered from ruthless exploitation and invasions by the Western powers and Japan. Trammeled by many unfair treaties signed by the defeated Qing government, China experienced a crisis of cultural self-confidence as its traditions shattered, its society disintegrated, and its empire perished. In the midst of this cultural, societal, and political turmoil, many intellectuals prescribed various remedies for the country’s survival; among them, Zhang Zhidong (1837-1909) was representative. In his Quanxue Pien (An Exhortation to Learning, 1898), Zhang called for importing Western industrial and economic knowledge and technology to meet China’s practical needs while at the same time preserving the leading position of Chinese traditional learning in theory. His response to the impact of Western knowledge is epitomized in the following phrases: “Taking Chinese learning as ‘substance,’ that is, the foundation of culture, and taking Western learning as ‘function’, that is, for the practical purpose and utility,” or to state briefly: “Chinese Learning as Substance and Western Learning as Function” (Zhongti Xiyong). This can be regarded as the first instance of the transformational trend in modern Chinese philosophy before the birth of modern China in 1911.

b. Sun Yat-sen

Sun Yat-sen (1866-1925), the Nationalist founder of the Republic of China, led the overthrow of the Qing regime in 1911 after a long series of revolutionary campaigns. Inspired by U.S. President Abraham Lincoln’s Gettysburg Address, in 1919 Sun articulated “Three Principles of the People” (Sanmin Zhuyi) on which the new democratic Republic of China was to be founded: the Principle of Nationalism (minzu zhuyi), the Principle of People’s Sovereignty (minquan zhuyi), and the Principle of People’s Livelihood (minsheng zhuyi).

The first principle, the Principle of Nationalism, which corresponds to Lincoln’s idea of “a government of the people,” maintains the equality of all ethnic groups in China proper and seeks equal national status for Chinese with all peoples of the world. This doctrine urges all ethnic groups (mainly the Han, Hui [Chinese Muslims], Manchus, Mongolians, and Tibetans) in China to unite as one nation so as to retrieve China’s national self-confidence and revitalize its national creativity. According to Sun, his Nationalism promoted eight kinds of national virtues: loyalty, fidelity, benevolence, love, honesty, justice, harmony, and peace, all of which have their origin in Chinese traditional culture but must be transformed to meet with the urgent needs of modern society.

The second principle, the Principle of People’s Sovereignty, which corresponds to Lincoln’s idea of “a government by the people,” holds that Chinese people must fight for their sovereignty through revolutions in order to set up a democratic government. According to Sun, Jean-Jacques Rousseau’s ideas that all men are born equal and people’s sovereignty is given by nature are merely ideals or theoretical hypotheses found in classic political texts. In human history, insisted Sun, no evidence can be found to support Rousseau’s views, and it was only through bloodshed that people ever acquired their power, sovereignty, and equality. Thus, Sun urged all Chinese to stand up for their rights, and to fight for their freedom and equality by joining the course of revolution. Influenced by the meritocratic Confucian civil service system of traditional China, Sun urged that most of the executive offices of the government be assigned by way of examination, instead of election. This is to separate people’s power from ability, so that people hold the power to govern while officials have the ability to serve (quanneng qufen).

The third principle, the Principle of People’s Livelihood, which corresponds to Lincoln’s idea of “a government for the people,” claims to provide a middle course between capitalism and communism and to avoid either extreme by substituting the idea of “cooperative economy” for that of “the free market.” Based on the Principle of People’s Livelihood, Sun argued for the adoption of two policies: (a) equalization of land ownership through taxation of property, and (b) restriction of private capital and expansion of state capital. Accordingly, the government should monopolize ownership and management of electricity, banking, mass transportation, and so forth, and leave medium- and small-sized businesses free room for their own development. Thus, the third Principle takes people’s livelihood in food, clothing, housing, and transportation to be of primary importance and demands that government assume full responsibility for this.

Above all, Sun proclaimed that his “Three Principles of the People” combined the choicest parts of Chinese and Western thinking with the Golden Mean (zhongyong) as a guideline derived from Chinese tradition. For example, the Principle of People’s Sovereignty accepts the Western idea of democracy but denies its origination from “natural law ”; as Sun observed, “all men are born unequal,” and those born with more intelligence and capability should serve those less favored by birth with compassion. To philosophers who demand scientific rigor and logical consistency, Sun’s synthesis may not sound convincing, and may seem to be largely based on personal observations and experience without theoretical justifications. However, from a historical perspective, Sun’s “Three Principles” may be seen as a major effort at introducing Western democratic ideas into China. In this sense, Sun’s attempt to combine Chinese tradition with Western modern thinking should be regarded as a typical example of the transformational trend in modern Chinese philosophy.

c. Chinese Scholasticism

The person who carried on the Christian tradition of Matteo Ricci in the early 20th century was Wu Jingxiong (1899-1986), also known as John C. H. Wu. A Roman Catholic and a scholar of jurisprudence, Wu became the first Chinese to translate the Bible into classical Chinese at the request of the Nationalist leader Chiang Kai-shek (1887-1975) in the 1930s. Wu saw Confucianism, Daoism and Chan Buddhism as the main currents in Chinese philosophy. He then tried to combine the AristotelianThomistic tradition with Chinese philosophy. In many of his works, such as “Mencius’ Theory of Human Nature and Natural Law,” “My Philosophy of Law: Natural Law in Evolution,” and “Comparative Studies in the Philosophy of Natural Law,” Wu argued that the Confucian Dao consists of a number of ethical principles which are parallel to the “natural laws” in Christian scholasticism. For instance, the Confucian concepts of “Heavenly Mandate” (tianming), “human nature,” and “edification” assume many similarities to the “eternal law,” “natural law,” and “positive law” of scholastic philosophy. (Shen 1993: 282-283) In a small pamphlet entitled “Joy in Chinese Philosophy,” published in the 1940s, Wu explicitly pointed out that Confucianism, Daoism and Chan Buddhism all display a kind of spiritual joy that can be subsumed under Christian joy. The Chinese scholastic tradition is still carried on today, with Fu Jen Catholic University in Taiwan as its center.

4. Anti-Traditional Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy

a. Yan Fu and Western Learning

The importation of Western science into China, prohibited since the early Qing, was renewed after the Opium War and gained tremendous momentum from the military supremacy of Western powers then invading China. To facilitate the introduction of Western military technology in manufacturing guns and building ships, the Jiangnan Arsenal, the first formal institution for Western learning in China, was established in 1865, followed by the construction of the Fuzhou Shipyard in 1866. The Qing government then changed its policy of isolation and sent the first group of young children abroad for foreign studies in 1872. Nonetheless, China’s disastrous defeat in the Sino-Japanese War of 1894-95 further weakened Chinese confidence in traditional culture and generated even greater enthusiasm among intellectuals for the West as a complete source of knowledge. Yan Fu (1853-1921), who studied in England from 1877 to 1879, was the first Chinese scholar to introduce Western philosophy, science, and political theory systematically by translating Thomas Huxley’s Evolution and Ethics, Herbert Spencer’s Synthetic Philosophy, John Stuart Mill’s On Liberty, Montesquieu’s L’Esprit des lois, and Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations into Chinese. (Fung 1976: 326) He advocated freedom of speech as the foundation of a civil society and thereby laid the foundation for democracy and liberalism to flourish in China in the early 20th century.

b. The May Fourth New Cultural Movement

Although he was an advocate of Western learning, Yan Fu rendered his translations of Western works in the archaic classical form of the Chinese language and consistently showed his respect for the traditional culture. In contrast, many of his followers turned their back on traditional culture and tried to forsake it completely. In fact, the major trend of modern Chinese philosophy could be characterized as an overall antagonism toward the intellectual and cultural traditions, which reached its height during the so-called “May Fourth New Cultural Movement” (wushi xinwenhua yundong). (Kwok 1965: 8-17)

Soon after Sun Yat-sen established the Republic of China, he was elected its President. He then abdicated his presidency to the warlord Yuan Shihkai (1859-1916). Yuan died after failing to restore the imperial regime with himself as emperor, leaving behind a corrupt government that secretly depended upon Japanese financing. In the beginning, the May Fourth Movement was purely a patriotic student movement provoked by the government’s intention to sign the Versailles Treaty (which promised to concede Germany’s monopoly in Shandong Province to Japan instead of giving it back to China, in spite of China’s contributions to the Allied Powers in the First World War). On May 4, 1919, Beijing University students demonstrated in protest against the government and burned the houses of the officials involved. The movement soon spread all over the whole country, many schools and business were closed down, and the Japanese goods were boycotted by the people as a sign of support for the student movement.

Politically, the movement was successful, as it prevented the government from signing the Versailles Treaty. But it also proved to be a fatal stroke to traditional culture and Chinese national confidence. Most of the student leaders in this movement, such as Hu Shi (1891-1962), Cai Yuanpei (1868-1940), Wu Zhihui (1865-1953), Wu Yu (1872-1949), Lo Jialun (1897-1969), Chen Duxiu (1897-1942), and Li Dazhao (1889-1927), later turned to the major figures of an even greater new cultural and political movement that was at first called the “Vernacular Movement” (paihaowen yundong), then the “New Cultural Movement” (xinwenhua yundong). The movement called for an overall reform of Chinese culture and made “Mr. Science and Ms. Democracy” its icons. The rebellious spirit provoked by the two slogans, which seemed to be the panacea for the desperate situation of China, ended by bringing about an extremely violent campaign against Confucianism. The movement then divided into two camps: one led by the liberal Hu Shi, the other led by the communist Chen Duxiu.

c. Hu Shi

Hu Shi, a student of John Dewey at Columbia University in the United States, invited his teacher to lecture at Shanghai when the May Fourth Movement broke out in Beijing. Hu soon became the chief leader of the New Cultural Movement by promoting a pragmatic, critical spirit and by applying “scientific method” in every branch of human studies. He proclaimed that archaic language failed to convey real-life experience and should be replaced by vernacular language in literature, that classical literature handed down from the remote past should be reexamined to determine whether it represented true experience or scholarly forgery, and that Confucianism had misled the Chinese people by teaching them to subordinate themselves to the authorities of sovereign, father, family, and the state. Similarly, Hu blamed Daoism for teaching the Chinese people to comply with nature, instead of understanding and controlling nature. Hu praised the early Chinese philosophical school known as Mohism–not because of its high moral commitment, but because he regarded it as possibly the earliest form of pragmatism in Chinese intellectual history. In this spirit of new literary movement, Hu Shi published the first book in Chinese vernacular language, Outlines of the History of Chinese Philosophy (1919), which dismissed the traditional sacred image of Confucianism. Above all, Hu advocated the scientific method in doing any research work with the maxim “make hypotheses boldly, but verify them carefully.” A believer in scientism, Hu advocated pragmatism and devalued traditional Chinese culture on the grounds that it was deficient in the elements of science and democracy.

d. Chen Duxiu

While Chen Duxiu shared Hu’s pro-democratic, pro-scientific, and anti-Confucian sentiments, he rejected Hu’s individualist liberalism and helped to found the Chinese Communist Party in 1921. Chen, editor of the most influential journal of the New Cultural Movement, New Youth, was influenced by French democratic thought and Russian Marxist theory. He saw Chinese traditions, chiefly Confucianism, as incompatible with science and democracy, and called for an end to what he saw as an emblem of obscurantism and dogmatism. Deeply impressed by French thinkers, he enumerated their achievements in democracy (as seen in the work of Lafayette and Seignobos), evolutionary theory (in Lamarck), and socialism (in Babeuf, Saint-Simon, and Fourier). Influenced by his predecessor Li Shizeng (1881-1973), the first Chinese to study in France and the transmitter of Pyotr Kropotkin’s anarchist doctrines prior to the May Fourth Movement, Chen once was an anarchist. He then came to embrace dialectical materialism and propagate Marxism strongly as the only remedy for a feeble China. In 1920, he wrote: “The republic cannot give happiness to the people…. Evolution goes from feudalism to republicanism and from republicanism to communism. I have said that the republic has failed and that feudalism has been reborn, but I hope that soon the feudal forces will be wiped out again by democracy and the latter by socialism…for I am convinced that the creation of a proletarian state is the most urgent revolution in China.” (Briere 1956: 24) These statements prefigure the birth of the People’s Republic of China which replaced the Republic of China as the regime in mainland China after 1949 and made Marxism the only authority in modern Chinese philosophy.

e. The Debate of 1923

The tide of anti-Confucianism reached another height in 1923 in “The Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists,” held chiefly by the geologist, Ding Wenjiang (1887-1936), and the Neo-Confucian thinker Zhang Junmei (1887-1969), later known as Carsun Chang. (Briere 1956: 16-17, 135-160; Kwok 1965: 29-31) Chang (Zhang), a disciple of Liang Qichao, gave a lecture on “the philosophy of life” at Qinghua University in Beijing in which he maintained that intuitive conscience and free will were the foundation of a happy life free from the sway of mechanical laws and argued that traditional Confucianism, including Neo-Confucianism, had made great contributions toward bringing about a great spiritual civilization by offering solutions for the problems of life to which science and technology had no answers. These remarks received an immediate rebuke from Ding in an article entitled “Science and Metaphysics,” in which he accused Chang of mixing Bergsonian intuitionism of élan vital with the intuitionism of Wang Yangming, thus recalling the specter of metaphysics in a positivist age. Ding, who championed the work of Darwin, Huxley, Spencer, et al, asserted that science is all-sufficient, not only in its subject matter, but also in its methodical procedure. According to Ding, science’s object is to search for universal truth by objectively excluding any personal, subjective prejudices, while the metaphysician can only introduce a supersensible world that is beyond human cognition and constructed from empty words.

In response, Chang retorted that manifestly there is knowledge outside of science, such as truths and hypotheses in philosophy and religion that cannot be verified by scientific criteria. Science, argued Chang, is far from being omnipotent: it is as limited in its scope as in its methods. Chang’s mentor, Liang Qichao, soon came to his aid and took on the role of an arbitrator in an article entitled “The View of Life and Science.” One the one hand, Liang criticized Chang for overstating the function of intuition and free will that leads to an undesirable subjective individualism and maintained that most of the “problems of life” can be solved with help of scientific knowledge. On the other hand, Liang supported Chang’s denial of the omnipotence of scientific knowledge and asserted that our understanding of beauty, love, religious experience, moral sentiment, aesthetic feeling, and so forth, can never proceed through scientific methods. (Briere 1956: 30)

The debate lasted more than one year. In addition to Liang Qichao, Liang Shuming (1893-1988) and Zhang Dungsun (1886-1962) sided with Chang, while Hu Shi, Chen Duxiu, Wu Zhihui and many others were in Ding’s camp. In the end, Ding’s “scientific” faction prevailed and paved the way for another wave of cultural reform, the so-called “Movement of Overall Westernization” (quanpan xihua) that sought a complete abandonment of traditional culture and a replacement of a backward, conservative way of life with a Westernized, modern way of life.

5. Traditional Trend in Modern Chinese Philosophy

a. Yang Rensan and the Buddhist Renaissance

In the early 20th century, the Chinese Buddhist school of Weishi, founded by Xuanzang during the Tang dynasty, was revived by Yang Rensan (1837-1911) and Ouyang Jinwu (1871-1943). Yang has been called the “Father of Modern Buddhism” because of his establishment of the “Nanjing Inscription Place for Sutras” (Jinglin Yinkechu) in 1866, which greatly contributed to the maintenance of Buddhist literature and the education of young monks. Yang advanced the Dashengcixin Lun (Essays on Awakening the Faith in Mahayana Buddhism) as the key work for understanding the essence of Buddha’s teaching. This text promotes the doctrine of “One Mind Opens Two Ways” (yixin kai ermen), according to which “Two Ways” refers to the Way of Real Mind (xinzhenru men) or the category of reality, noumena, suchness, and so forth, and the Way of Passing Mind (xinshengmei men), or the category of appearance, phenomena, ephemerality, and so on. In Yang’s understanding, the doctrine of “One Mind Opens Two Ways” provides a full account of life and death, which is the basic concern of Buddhism. All Buddhist practices aim at helping people to achieve Buddhahood and freedom from suffering, conditioned existence in cyclical rebirth (samsara). For Yang, these aims are made possible because both one’s suffering and one’s redemption from suffering coexist in one’s mind. Once one discovers his immaculate nature, which is pure, pristine, changeless and irremovable, then he will achieve Buddhahood. However, if he is entangled by ignorance, greed, anger, wantonness, and evils, then he will continue to suffer from cyclical birth and death (although essentially these will not affect his immaculate nature). Thus in Yang’s view, the study of mind and consciousness (in the sense of activity-consciousness or yehshi) is of primal importance and can be best accomplished through this type of Buddhist discipline.

b. Ou-Yang Jingwu and the Chinese Academy of Buddhism

Yang’s idea deeply impressed his disciple Ouyang Jingwu, a forerunner of both modern Chinese Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism (whose leading figure, Xiong Shili [1885-1968], was a disciple of Ouyang). Ouyang originally was a Neo-Confucian familiar with Zhu Xi and Wang Yangming who eventually tired of the “empty talk” of Neo-Confucianism and became interested in Yang’s Weishi Buddhism. In 1922, carrying on Yang’s career of reprinting Buddhist literature and promoting Buddhist education, Ouyang founded the Chinese Academy of Buddhism (Zhina Neixueyuan) at Nanjing, which soon became the center for Weishi studies. Ouyang himself republished the most important classic of Weishi, the Yogacaryabhumi Sastra (Yoga Masters on the Spiritual Levels of Buddhist Practice or Yujiashidi Lun), with an introduction that was highly praised by the Buddhist academic community of the time. Before this, in 1921, he gave a lecture entitled “Buddhist Teaching is neither a Religion nor a Philosophy” at Nanjing Normal High School in which he distinguished Buddhism from both religion and philosophy. In Ouyang’s view, Buddhism does not teach the belief in the existence of God or gods, nor does it maintain any relations coalescing God and man, so it should not be regarded as a “religion” in the Western theistic sense. Again, the term “philosophy” does not apply to Buddhism either, as the former has no concern of the ultimate destiny of man and pays no attention to achieving the highest spiritual status through self-cultivation. Thus, Ouyang praised Buddhism as the all-encompassing learning that covers cosmology, epistemology, psychology, and the issue of life and death–as the only learning, in fact, that will help people to solve the problem of life and death.

Although a faithful follower of Yang, Ouyang did not accept all his master’s views without reservation. He differed from Yang in his understanding of the significance and adequacy of the Essays on Awakening the Faith in Mahayana Buddhism. Yang appreciated the work for its union of “reality” with “appearance” in one mind; Ouyang, however, criticized this doctrine severely according to the principle of “Distinguishing Substance from Function” (jianbie tiyong). Ouyang argued that “reality” or suchness indicates the substance and essence of a thing, whereas “appearance” or the sensible merely indicates the function or work of a thing. These two belong to different levels of category and should not be taken indiscriminately, as the Essays do. Ouyang then tried to go beyond Weishi, and studied Avatamsaka Sutra and Mahaparinirvana Sutra in his later years with the purpose of expanding and advancing modern Buddhist thought. With his effort, Chinese Buddhism flourished once again in the early 1920s and ’30s, and many celebrities such as Liang Qichao and Cai Yuanpei came to Ouyang’s help to sponsor the Chinese Academy of Buddhism. His thought has proven to be quite influential on subsequent Chinese Buddhist and Neo-Confucian thinkers, including Tai Xu (1890-1947), Lu Cheng (1896-1989), and the aforementioned Xiong Shili.

c. Liang Shuming and Neo-Confucianism

The Buddhist renaissance mentioned above may be regarded as the most insulated quarter of modern Chinese philosophy, insofar as it paid no attention to the prevalence of Western philosophy in China and maintained itself firmly on the traditional track. Modern Confucianism, however, pursued a combined course, partly following the traditional way and partly transforming itself in response to the challenge of Western culture. Among the traditional Confucianists, the late Qing reformer and mentor of Liang Qichao, Kang Yuwei (1858-1927), might be regarded as the last Confucian who was convinced that China could solve its problems by traditional learning alone. Even after the complete rejection of Confucianism by Hu Shi and Chen Duxiu in the early 1920s, Confucianism still retained its defenders. Most notable among these was Liang Shuming, who published Dongxiwenhua jichizhexue (The Oriental and Occidental Cultures and Their Philosophies) in 1922. In this book, Liang attempted a macro-scale analysis of Eastern and Western cultures and divided the development of world cultures into three different stages: (1) the objective, (2) the moderate, and (3) the divine, which correspond to three kinds of life attitude — the outward, the inward, and the backward, respectively. According to Liang, modern European culture with its objective spirit should be ascribed to the first stage. People who live in this culture aim to understand and exploit nature in order to satisfy their mounting needs and desires, and therefore assume an outward life attitude, an attitude of aggression, striving, progression, and competition. In Liang’s view, Chinese culture could be ascribed to the second stage, as the Chinese knew quite well that excess desire for material goods undermines the true happiness of humankind. Without undergoing the first stage, Chinese culture came directly to the second stage and thus was in fact morally precocious, adopting an inward life attitude of moderation and pursuing the equilibrium of humanity and nature, a harmonization of reason and emotions. Finally, Liang saw Indian culture as representative of the last stage, in which high wisdom teaches people to abstain from desire and pleasure and make them assume a backward life attitude toward this sensual world. “In short,” Liang argued, “it is necessary to reject Indian culture as useless, to modify Western culture with true happiness in view, and to reassert the value of Chinese culture.” In Liang’s optimistic vision, “The world culture will eventually be the renovated Chinese culture.” Thus from a more or less spiritualistic outlook, Liang provided a different evaluation of Chinese traditional culture by offering a broader picture of the total developments of human civilization and its destiny, though without founding arguments.

d. Fung Yulan and Neo-Confucianism

The renowned scholar Fung Yulan (1895-1990), a contemporary of Liang, was another important figure in the camp of Confucian defense. Fung, like Hu, had also been a student of John Dewey, as he studied at Columbia University from 1919 to 1924 and received his Ph.D. there. He then returned to China, where he mainly taught at Qinghua University and edited a professional journal, Philosophical Critique (1927-1937), with Hu Shi, Carsun Chang, Zhang Dongsun, et al. In 1934, Fung published the first volume of his History of Chinese Philosophy, which was translated into English in 1937 and became the first book on this subject in English. From 1939 to 1947, Fung published a series of books under the title of Xinlixue (New Rational Philosophy) that made him the initiator of modern Neo-Confucian movement. Carrying on the traditions of Song and Ming Neo-Confucianism, Fung’s “New Rational Philosophy” was based on four concepts: principle (li), material force (qi), the substance of Dao or Way (daoti), and the Great Whole (daquan). Roughly speaking, Fung assumed a realist outlook and laid out the basic tenets of his philosophy as follows. First, everything exists as something really exists, and it is inherent within itself as a “principle” that makes it what it is. Second, everything exists by taking its shape from material force; since the “principle” is eternal, universal, and abstract, there must be something that is temporal, particular, and concrete to make a thing really exist. Third, whatever exists, exists in a flux. The totality of ephemeral phenomena and the transient world is called the substance of Dao. Fourth, the totality of whatever exists, the ultimate existence, is called the Great Whole. Borrowing the totalistic concept from Buddhism, Fung sees the Great Whole as an indication that, in the ultimate reality, “one is all and all is one.” In addition, The Great Whole is also the life-purpose of a philosopher who tries to understand the external world, to realize his potential abilities, and to serve Heaven: that is, to fulfill humanity. Thus, Fung was basically a Neo-Confucian of Zhu Xi’s type, who maintained that universal principles should be the foundations of a moral cosmos in which humanity can be fulfilled. This can be seen in Fung’s paper “Chinese Philosophy and a Future World Philosophy,” published in 1948 by The Philosophical Review, which makes comparisons between Plato and Zhu Xi, Immanuel Kant and the Daoists, and establishes human perfection as the major goal of Confucianism.

e. Carsun Chang and Neo-Confucianism

Though Fung was the first modern Chinese philosopher who carried on the traditions of Song and Ming Neo-Confucianism by elaborating its metaphysical systems, it was Carsun Chang who literally gave birth to the term “Neo-Confucianism” or Xinjujia and provided a great impetus to the later “New Confucian” movement in Hong Kong and Taiwan. As mentioned before, in the “Debate of 1923,” Chang allied himself with Liang Qichao and Liang Shuming in fighting against the torrents of anti-Confucianism and scientism. However, like Fung, Chang was acquainted with Western culture and studied abroad in Japan and Germany. In 1918, Chang studied with the German idealist Rudolf Eucken at Jena University. Despite his interest in philosophy, he threw himself into politics and founded a party which was at first called “National Socialist,” and then “Social Democrat.” In 1957, after immigrating to the United States, Chang returned to his past interests and wrote The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought, which gives a full account of Neo-Confucianism from the Tang thinker Han Yu (768-824) to the beginning of the early Republican period and freely associates Neo-Confucianism and Chan Buddhism with Western idealism and liberalism. The book was the first work on Neo-Confucianism in English and in it, Chang coined the term “Neo-Confucianism,” since widely used by academics in both the East and the West.

f. Xiong Shili and Neo-Confucianism

Another representative of modern Neo-Confucianism was Xiong Shili. Xiong was deeply influenced by Ouyang’s Buddhist thought, but rejected his teacher’s doctrine of “Distinguishing Substance from Function.” In 1944, he wrote Xinweishi lun (New Doctrine of Consciousness-Only) in which he attempted to synthesize Chan Buddhism with the idealism of Neo-Confucianism and to criticize the Consciousness-Only school. According to Xiong, reality is in perpetual transformation, consisting of unceasing “closing” and “opening” movements, with everything arising from these movements. The universe in its “closing” aspect is prone to integrate substantial things, and the outcome may be called “matter.” While in its opening aspect, the universe intends to maintain its own nature and be its own master, and the outcome may be called “mind.” This mind itself is one part of the “original mind,” which implies the activities of consciousness and will as well. Both “closing” and “opening” are the functions of the universe, but they are the manifestations of the substance of the universe, too. Thus, there should be no separation or distinction of “substance” from “function,” as the “Consciousness-Only” school taught. The “Consciousness-Only” school maintains that there are two different realms, namely, the realm of temporality or phenomena (the realm of alaya) and the realm of suchness or noumena. Taking alaya as the cause of the consciousness, consciousness becomes the effect of alaya. In Xiong’s view, all these separations are due to the misleading doctrine of “Distinguishing Substance from Function” and should be lifted according to the doctrine of “Substance as Function.” Here, the concepts of “closing” and “opening” seem to be adopted from the Book of Changes and become the cornerstones of Xiong’s cosmology. Thus, with a strong inclination to Wang Yangming’s idealism, Xiong made personal experience and self-awareness the only foundation of reality, which his critics maintained failed to do justice to the objective existence of the universe.

Xiong’s Neo-Confucian thought exercised great influence on his followers, especially Mou Zongsan (1909-1995) and Tang Junyi (1909-1978). After 1958, Mou and Tang taught at the the Chinese University of Hong Kong’s New Asia College and made Neo-Confucianism a popular school within modern Chinese philosophy.

g. Wang Kuowei and Classical Confucianism

Although Neo-Confucianism was predominant in modern Chinese philosophy, there was an unpopular strain of thought derived from the tradition of “classical Confucianism” of the early Qing that stood in opposition to Neo-Confucianism. The arguments between the two can be traced back to Wang Kuowei (1877-1927)’s critique of Zhang Zhidong’s denial of the value of philosophy. After its defeat in the Boxers’ Rebellion of 1900 by the Alliance of Eight Nations, the Qing government finally determined to implement its “New Policy” for constitutional and educational reforms. Zhang Zhidong was in charge of educational reform and assigned the office to stipulate the articles for the establishment of modern schools in China. As noted above, Zhang held a doctrine of “Chinese Learning as Substance and Western Learning as Function,” and contrived to preserve the dominant position of traditional learning. As a Neo-Confucian, Zhang took the Lixue of the Song as the authority of traditional learning and deemed Western philosophy to be poisonous, useless, and incompatible with Lixue, on the grounds that democratic theories in Western philosophy might spread dangerous ideas of freedom and human rights throughout China and result in unpredictable social upheavals. He then decided to eliminate “philosophy” from the undergraduate curriculum and replace it with “Neo-Confucianism.” Zhang’s decision was severely criticized by Wang Kuowei in his Zhexue Pienhuo (An Answer to the Doubt of Philosophy) (1903). Wang accused Zhang of espousing a narrow-minded, vulgar Confucian mode of thinking that attempted to grant a franchise to Neo-Confucianism in an era seeking for freedom of thought. He argued that philosophy should not be deemed poisonous or useless as it comprises broader scope than politics and jurisprudence that teaches the ideas of freedom and equality, and utility should never be taken as a standard to which philosophy has to meet. The function of philosophy is to answer the metaphysical impetus of human beings for truth, goodness and beauty, instead of the need for utility. Deeply impressed by the systematic and logical rigorousness of Western philosophy, Wang contended that Western philosophy was a necessary intellectual resource for scholars who wished to analyze and reinterpret Chinese philosophy. Again, the value of Confucianism can only be properly estimated after one has full knowledge and an overall understanding of all the teachings of Chinese and Western philosophy. Neo-Confucianism is but only one of the Confucian schools and Confucianism is but only one of the schools of Chinese philosophy alongside Daoism, Mohism, Legalism, and so forth. Thus, Wang saw no reason to make Neo-Confucianism the authority of traditional learning or to exclude the teaching of Western philosophy from universities. Accordingly, Wang suggested that scholars expand the scope of traditional learning and to go beyond Neo-Confucianism or even Confucianism.

It is worth noting that Wang Kuowei himself was the first Chinese scholar to introduce Western philosophy with better understanding and deeper insight than Yan Fu. Before he was thirty, Wang had already studied Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason and Schopenhauer’s The Fourfold Root of the Principle of Sufficient Reason, The World as Will and Representation, and On the Will in Nature through Japanese and English translations, and was deeply impressed by the two German philosophers. When dealing with the most abstruse European philosophy, Wang admitted that he could hardly understand Kant. It was through studying Schopenhauer’s criticism of Kant’s doctrine of “thing-in-itself” that Kant became apprehensible to him. Wang was also familiar with Thomas Hobbes, Francis Bacon, John Locke , David Hume, Jeremy Bentham, and other Western thinkers by studying Henry Sidgwick’s Outlines of the History of Ethics. One would not be going too far in saying that Wang was the first Chinese scholar with such a broad knowledge of Western philosophy. Nonetheless, after the age of thirty, Wang gave up the study of philosophy and turned to Chinese classics, history and literature, which made him eventually one of the greatest Chinese historians, archaeologists, and men of letters. The brilliant scholar ended his own life in the Kunming Lake of Yihe Royal Garden when he was only fifty years old.

h. Thome Fang and Classical Confucianism

Among the modern Chinese philosophers who flourished in the early 1930s, Thome Fang (1899-1977) was the true follower of Wang Kuowei. He shared Wang’s refutation of the narrowness of Neo-Confucianism and confirmed Wang’s assertion of the significance of philosophy. Like Wang, Fang had received a solid classical education as a result of his family upbringing, from which he developed a strong conviction of the preeminence of traditional Chinese culture. He also had a comprehensive knowledge of Western philosophy, having received his Ph.D. in philosophy from the University of Wisconsin at Madison in 1924. Fang was in fact the first Chinese scholar to introduce a number of Western writers, including ancient Greek tragedians and the philosophers George Santayana and Alfred North Whitehead, to Chinese readers. When he began his philosophical career in 1926 by teaching at the Central University of Nanjing, he published a series of papers on science, philosophy, and life. In these papers Fang gave high appraisal to Whitehead’s opposition to scientific materialism and agreed to Whitehead’s criticism of the fallacies of “bifurcation of nature” and “misplaced concreteness,” which are the presuppositions of scientific knowledge. Among the various Western philosophical strains, Fang found that Greek philosophy was the one closest to original Confucianism and saw Whitehead’s concept of nature as “creative advance” as parallel to the concept of “creativity” in the Book of Changes, whereas he regarded modern European philosophy as constantly trapped by all kinds of dualism and thus at variance with Chinese philosophy. In “Three Types of Philosophical Wisdom” (1938), Fang maintained that there are three types of philosophical wisdom, the ancient Greek, the modern European and the classic Chinese, which represent the most significant cultural aspects in the development of human history. In Fang’s account, the ancient Greeks praised reason and took reality to be the realm of the intelligible, the modern Europeans scrutinized nature and developed science and technology successfully, whereas the Chinese eulogized humanity and enshrined universal principles–Dao–in the highest place of their philosophical system. Thus for Fang the Greek speculative wisdom, the European technological wisdom and the Chinese moderate wisdom can be characterized by rationality, efficiency, and universal equity respectively. And if these three types of wisdom can be incorporated into a coherent whole, with one complementing to the others, so Fang imagined, the most desirable form of world culture would emerge.

In addition, according to Fang, Chinese wisdom is best represented by Confucius’s interpretations of the Book of Changes, Laozi’s doctrine of Dao, and Mozi’s ideal of mutual love, which he saw as the most important elements of Chinese philosophy. In contrast, Fang rejected sectarian Daoism and Neo-Confucianism as decadent forms of original Daoism and Confucianism, insofar as sectarian Daoism is greatly involved with popular folk beliefs and yinyang theory and Neo-Confucianism transforms the cosmology of the Book of Changes into a kind of materialistic cosmogony. Even so, Fang was the first modern Chinese philosopher who recognized the philosophical significance of the Book of Changes, convening regular meetings with several scholars to explore and discuss the philosophical implications of this classic text from 1935 to 1937 in Nanjing and jointly publishing Yixue Taolunji (A Collection of Papers on the Book of Changes) (1937), the first work to study the Book of Changes in connection with Western philosophy, inspiring a new generation of Chinese scholars to approach the text in this way.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Briere, O. Fifty Years of Chinese Philosophy 1898-1950. Trans. Laurence G. Thompson. London: George Allen and Unwin, 1956.
  • Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
  • Chang, Carsun. The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought. New York: Bookman Associates, 1957.
  • Dubs, Homer H. “Recent Chinese Philosophy.” The Journal of Philosophy 35 (1938): 345-355. Fang, Thome. Chinese Philosophy: Its Spirit and Its Development. Taipei: Linking Publishing Co., Ltd., 1981.
  • Fung, Yu-lan, “Chinese Philosophy and a Future World Philosophy.” The Philosophical Review 57 (1948): 539-549.
  • Fung, Yu-lan. A Short History of Chinese Philosophy. Ed. Derk Bodde. New York: The Free Press, 1976.
  • Kwok, D.W.Y. Scientism in Chinese Thought, 1900-1950. New Haven and London: Yale University Press, 1965.
  • Schwartz, Benjamin I. In Search of Wealth and Power: Yen Fu and the West. Cambridge: Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, 1964.
  • Shen, Vincent. “Creativity as Synthesis of Contrasting Wisdoms: An Interpretation of Chinese Philosophy in Taiwan since 1949.” Philosophy East and West A Quarterly of Comparative Philosophy 43 (1993): 179-287.
  • Sun, Yat-sen. The Three Principles of the People. Trans. Frank W. Price. Taipei: China Publishing Company, 1981.

Author Information

Yih-Hsien Yu
Email: arche@thu.edu.tw
Tunghai University
Taiwan

Medieval Theories of Free Will

Why do human beings perform the actions they perform? What moves them to act? Why do we blame a human being for knocking over the vase and not the family dog? What gives us the idea that we are free to choose as we wish, that we have free will? These and other questions about human action have fascinated philosophers for centuries. Throughout the thousand year period of the Middle Ages, scholars provided a wide variety of different answers to these questions. These thinkers developed theories both remarkable and original in their own right that continue to be of interest to scholars working in this area today. While they shared an understanding of human psychology and enjoyed a common intellectual heritage, they nevertheless maintained a lively and diverse conversation on this topic throughout the whole of the Middle Ages, providing us with a sophisticated intellectual inheritance.

This article considers a wide range of theories written throughout the Middle Ages, from the foundational work of Augustine in the early part of the period through that of John Duns Scotus at the end. It notes the ways in which later work on the topic builds upon that developed earlier, shows the lively disagreements that often arose on the topic, and, although medieval thinkers worked within a different framework than philosophers do today, reveals how their discussions share certain affinities.

Table of Contents

  1. Medieval and Current Understandings of Free Will
  2. Individual Theories – the Early Middle Ages
    1. Augustine
    2. Anselm of Canterbury
    3. Bernard of Clairvaux
  3. Individual Theories – Sentences Commentaries
    1. Peter Lombard
    2. Albert the Great
  4. Individual Theories – the High Middle Ages
    1. Thomas Aquinas
    2. John Duns Scotus
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Medieval and Current Understandings of Free Will

Although at first glance it might not seem so, medieval philosophers were concerned with many of the same issues that interest philosophers today. The current discussion of action focuses on the topic of free will: whether free will is compatible with causal determinism, and the relationship between free will and moral responsibility. Medieval thinkers also discussed many of these issues; for example, they accept the common intuition that unless one acts freely, one cannot be held morally responsible for what one does. But the structure of their discussion often makes it difficult to recognize the extent to which their concerns both resemble and deviate from the current debate. Thinkers in the early part of the Middle Ages discussed human action and freedom in the context of broader theological concerns such as the problem of evil or the effects of the Fall, that is, the sin of the first human beings. As the Middle Ages progressed, scholars became more interested in discussing the nature of freedom for its own sake, apart from the particular theological problems in which free will forms an important part of their solution. Thus, discussions of free will become embedded in larger treatises of human psychology. This is not to say that later theorists lost interest in those theological problems; rather, discussions of the two issues diverged from each other and became discrete subjects of investigation.

Medieval philosophers did not ask the question whether free will was compatible with causal determinism, not because they did not understand the ramifications of cause and effect or because they lacked a scientific notion of the world. They recognized the regularities of the world and understood the implications of a mechanistic world-view. They did not ask this question because they accepted the position that the freedom of human action is incompatible with causal determinism and because they believed that human beings in fact do act freely, at least on some occasions. Thus, in current terms, they were libertarians about human freedom. They argued that human beings are importantly different from other animals and the rest of creation. Human beings act freely because they possess rational capacities, which are lacking in other animals. Rational capacities enable human beings to act freely because those capacities are immaterial. How does the immateriality of those capacities enable human beings to act freely? The argument, roughly, is as follows: Everything else in the world is made of matter and thus is material or physical. Material things are governed by particular laws and so are determined to particular activities. If human beings were wholly material, then their actions would also be determined and they would not act freely. But because the capacities that bring about action are immaterial in nature, and hence, not governed by physical laws, actions that come about as a result of those capacities will be uncoerced, at least under ordinary circumstances. According to medieval accounts of freedom, then, freedom is incompatible with causal determinism (although medieval philosophers would not express the point in these terms). Since they all agree on this issue, medieval accounts of freedom then attempt to answer the question “how is it that human beings are able to act freely?” The answer to this question was hotly contested.

All medieval theorists agreed that human beings have a soul that enables them to perform the actions that they perform. As the era progressed, theories of human psychology grew more and more elaborate, but even in the earliest theories, two capacities in particular stood out: the intellect and the will. The intellect is the human capacity to cognize. The will is the human motivational capacity; it is the capacity that moves us to do what we do. The will depends upon the intellect to identify what alternatives for action are possible and desirable. It is on the basis of these intellectually cognized alternatives that the will chooses. Medieval theorists recognized that it is the human being who thinks and who acts, but it is in virtue of having an intellect and having a will that human beings are able to do what they do. Talk about what the intellect thinks or what the will does is a kind of shorthand for what the individual does in virtue of those capacities In light of a common theory of human psychology, the medieval debate centered upon whether human beings act freely primarily in virtue of their wills or in virtue of their intellects. Those who argue that freedom is primarily a function of the intellect are known as intellectualists while those who argue that freedom is primarily a function of the will are known as voluntarists, from the Latin word for will, voluntas.

2. Individual Theories – the Early Middle Ages

a. Augustine

Augustine was interested in the topic of human action and freedom because he needed to explain how it is that God is not responsible for the presence of evil in the world while at the same time holding that God sustains and governs the world. On his view, human beings do evil things when they give in to their desires for the temporal things instead of pursuing eternal things such as knowledge, virtue, and God. His theory of human nature is rather rudimentary, but it helps to establish the foundation for later more elaborate accounts. Human beings possess the rational capacities of intellect and will as well as sensory capabilities and desire. Human beings perceive the world around them, including what things are available to be pursued, through their senses. Such data can also stimulate basic desires. This information is fed to the intellect, which makes judgments about the contents of perception and desire. Choices as to what to do are made in virtue of the will. Augustine argues that desire can never overwhelm an agent; because they have intellects and wills, agents are not determined by basic bodily desires. Rather, an agent gives in to desire in virtue of the will, which operates freely and never under compulsion. In fact, if a will were ever coerced, Augustine says it would not be a will. Thus, human beings commit sins freely by giving into the desire for temporal things, which the intellect and will could disregard in favor of the eternal things that human beings ought to pursue. Since human beings act freely, Augustine argues that they, and not God, are responsible for evil in the world.

Early in his career, Augustine was very optimistic about the human ability to resist temptation and sin. He argued that all one had to do in order to avoid sin was simply to will against it. This got him into a bit of trouble with a particular heresy of the time – Pelagianism. Pelagius was a contemporary of Augustine’s who held that human beings are able to bring about their own salvation and do not require grace from God. This position contradicts the traditional Christian view of the Fall of Adam and Eve and the need for the Incarnation of Jesus and grace from God. Not surprisingly, Pelagius took Augustine’s early writings to be favorable to his own position. Augustine argued that Pelagius misinterpreted his early views, and in his later writings, he was much more careful to insist upon the pernicious effects of sin upon human behavior and the need for God’s grace in order to avoid sin and achieve salvation. This sets up a tension with his insistence upon free will that exercised the minds of later theorists and one that Augustine himself did not entirely resolve.

b. Anselm of Canterbury

Anselm‘s account of action and freedom reflects a broadly Augustinian framework. Like Augustine, Anselm describes human action in terms of the workings of intellect and will. Anselm also accepts the view that unless human beings act freely, they cannot be held responsible for their actions and God will be blamed for sin. Worries over the effect of sin and grace also help to structure his account.

Anselm rejects the notion that one must be able to act in ways other than they do in order to be free. If freedom had to be defined in these terms, then God, the good angels, the blessed in heaven, the bad angels, and the damned in hell could not be free since they lack this ability to do otherwise. God, the good angels, and the blessed cannot bring about evil while the bad angels and the damned cannot bring about the good. In the medieval theological tradition, God is perfectly good so it is not possible for God to will or perform evil. Medieval theologians also argued that rational beings (human beings, angels) admitted into heaven are confirmed in the good in such a way that they are unable to choose what is bad, while rational beings who are sent to hell are confirmed in evil in such a way that they are unable to chose what is good. But Anselm believes that all of these individuals act freely even though they cannot act in ways other than they do. This is especially the case for God, who is the freest of them all. Therefore, Anselm argues freedom cannot consist in the ability to do otherwise; another account of freedom must be developed. The question, then, is how does Anselm understand the notion of freedom?

Anselm presents two different accounts of freedom, which nevertheless are related. In De libertate arbitrii (commonly translated as On Freedom of Choice), he defines freedom as “the ability to preserve uprightness of will for its own sake.” He argues that rational beings have this ability insofar as they possess intellects by which they come to understand how to preserve uprightness of will and insofar as they possess the will itself in virtue of which they will to preserve that uprightness. This might seem like a strange definition of freedom, but given the connection to moral responsibility, Anselm understands freedom not in terms of being able to act differently than one does. Rather, he understands freedom in terms of whether one has the ability to do the right thing for the right reason. It is obvious that God, the good angels, and the blessed in heaven all possess this ability, but what about sinners in this life, who from the Christian perspective are now slaves to sin in virtue of their sin? One can raise an analogous worry about the demons and the damned in hell, both of whom are confirmed in evil. Anselm needs to explain how they retain the ability to do the right thing given that they are unable to do the right thing.

Anselm explains this seemingly contradictory situation by drawing upon a distinction between possessing an ability and exercising that ability. Because sinners, demons, and the damned all possess intellect and will, they retain the ability to preserve uprightness of will. They are, however, unable to exercise that ability because of the hindrance of sin. Anselm explains this by analogy with sight. One retains the ability to see a mountain even though on a cloudy day, one cannot in fact see it due to the hindrance of the clouds. Similarly, one who is a slave to sin or who is confirmed in evil retains the ability to maintain uprightness of will even though one cannot actually maintain that uprightness because being a slave to sin or confirmation in evil hinders one from doing so. Thus, Anselm agrees with Augustine that it takes an act of God to restore the sinner to a state of grace, although human beings are capable of losing that grace by their own evil (and free) choices.

Anselm’s second account of freedom can be called the “two-wills account.” In his treatise, On the Fall of the Devil, he develops a thought-experiment in which he imagines that God is creating an angel from scratch. At the point where God has given the angel under construction only a will for happiness, the angel cannot act freely. For at this point, the angel is necessitated to will happiness and those things required for its happiness and is not able to refrain from willing happiness. Thus, the angel’s act of willing happiness is not free, for the angel could will nothing but happiness. Anselm then asks whether the situation would be any different should God give the angel only a will for justice, In this case, Anselm insists that the angel does not will justice freely since the angel is necessitated to will justice and is not able not to will justice. Only when God gives the angel both a will for happiness and a will for justice does the angel will freely. For now the angel is not necessitated to will happiness, for he could will justice; nor is the angel necessitated to will justice, for he could will happiness.

There are several questions that come to mind about this second account of freedom. First, there is the worry that Anselm is now relying on a principle that he rejected in the first account of freedom, that is, the idea that freedom requires the ability to do otherwise. Secondly, one can ask about the relationship between the two accounts. This second issue is easier to address than the first. One can see in Anselm’s two-wills account of freedom a further development of how the will of the first account is able to maintain uprightness of will for its own sake. If the will had only the will for justice, it would will justice, not because it is the right thing to do, but because it must do so. If the will had only the will for happiness, then it could not will justice at all. Thus, it is only when the will has both the will for justice and the will for happiness that the will has the ability to maintain uprightness for the sake of uprightness. That is to say that the will has the ability to will the right thing (that is, justice) for the right reason.

The first issue is harder to resolve. Anselm implies that having the will for happiness means that one need not will justice and vice versa. Thus, one who has both wills is able to will justly or not, as it pleases the agent. This implies that the one who follows the will for justice could have abandoned justice to follow the will for happiness and vice versa. But this implies the ability to act otherwise and also implies that God and the blessed could abandon justice for happiness while the demons and the damned could abandon happiness for justice, both of which Anselm denies. The answer to this conundrum lies in Anselm’s reply to a third issue raised by his discussion.

This third issue addresses the apparent implication that the pursuit of justice could require an agent to sacrifice her own happiness. For in following the will for justice, the agent turns away from the will for happiness and vice versa. This implies that an agent could be in a situation where doing what is right will make her unhappy. Anselm responds by arguing that genuine happiness never conflicts with justice. When agents are struggling between the demands of morality and happiness, the happiness in question is only apparent. For example, consider the college student who is tempted to spend the scholarship money, not on her tuition, but rather on a new car. Obviously she ought to pay the tuition bill, but she really, really wants the car and thinks she’ll be much happier with it. Anselm would argue that in the long run, the education will make her happier; for one thing, the hope is that it will lead to a better paying job that will enable her to get the car. Thus, doing the right thing in the long run will coincide with her happiness, regardless of whether she recognizes this in the short run. Anselm characterizes the will for happiness as a will for our own benefit, what we think will be advantageous to ourselves, what appears desirable to us, regardless of whether it in fact will make us happy. What actually makes us happy is pursuing happiness in the right way, that is, by doing what is in fact the right thing to do. Thus, for Anselm, there is no actual conflict between happiness and justice.

This answer helps him to resolve the first issue. The agent who acts justly simply because it is the right thing to do de facto satisfies the will for happiness. Those who act justly for its own sake recognize the connection between justice and happiness and so would not forsake justice for the sake of happiness; it would be inconceivable to them to do so. But they act freely insofar as they are not necessitated to justice in virtue of having both wills. Thus, they act freely even though they cannot act otherwise. Those who are confirmed in evil fail or failed to take seriously the connection between justice and genuine happiness. They have chosen to follow the will for happiness and, by pursuing the will for happiness in an unjust manner, forsake justice. Because they are fixed upon their own happiness, it would be inconceivable to them to pursue the will for justice even though they realize that they would be better off to do so. But they act freely insofar as they are not necessitated to happiness in virtue of having both wills. Thus, they act freely even though they cannot act otherwise.

c. Bernard of Clairvaux

Bernard (1090-1153) is not often thought of in connection with philosophy; he was an abbot and an important religious reformer as well as a prominent promoter of the First Crusade. But he wrote a short treatise titled On Grace and Free Will that was rather influential during the twelfth and first half of the thirteenth centuries. Although Bernard is mainly concerned with theological worries such as the influence of grace upon human freedom, he contributes to the voluntarist climate of the Middle Ages. He moves the discussion even further than either Augustine or Anselm, for he is one of the first medieval theorists to define the will as a rational appetite, that is, an appetite that is responsive to reasons. Such an idea is merely nascent in Anselm.

Like Augustine and Anselm before him, Bernard acknowledges that moral responsibility requires that human beings perform their actions freely. He argues that human beings act freely primarily in virtue of the will. The intellect is not entirely irrelevant; Bernard claims that only those who have an intellect and are capable of engaging in thought are capable of acting freely. Thus, children, non-rational animals, and the mentally handicapped do not act freely. As they mature, however, children become more able to do so, as do those who recover from mental illness. Nevertheless, the intellect is merely an instrument by which the will is able to exercise its primary activity, which is to choose. The will depends upon the intellect to identify what choices are available from which the will can choose. We cannot choose what we are not aware of. But once the intellect has made apparent potential alternatives for action, its job is finished. The will makes the final choice of what is to be done. Thus, it is ultimately in virtue of the will that human beings perform free actions. Furthermore, on Bernard’s account, the will is so free that nothing can determine its choices, not even the intellect. He argues that the will is free to will against a judgment of the intellect. For example, the intellect could judge that some action is against God’s decrees, and therefore not to be done, yet the will could still choose this action. Such cases, of course, happen all the time, and Bernard argues that if the will were not free to will against a particular judgment of the intellect, that would in essence destroy it. This idea that the will is able to will against a judgment of intellect will be an important claim in the late thirteenth century debates.

3. Individual Theories – Sentences Commentaries

a. Peter Lombard

Peter Lombard was a twelfth-century bishop of Paris and a theologian at what was to become the University of Paris. The final edition of his most famous work, Sententiae in IV libris distinctae, was released for circulation somewhere around 1155-57. This book became the standard theological textbook at universities throughout Europe from the thirteenth into the sixteenth centuries. It is divided into four books, the first of which has to do with God; the second, with creatures, both human and angelic, and their fall from grace; the third, with the incarnation and redemption of Jesus; and the fourth with the instruments of redemption, that is, the virtues and the sacraments. Writing a commentary on the Sentences became a standard student practice at universities during the Middle Ages.

Although use of the Latin phrase, liberum arbitrium, goes all the back to Augustine, Lombard provides a definition for it that dominates the discussion of freedom in the first half of the thirteenth century: liberum arbitrium is a faculty of intellect and will. This term, for which there is no satisfactory English translation, refers to that power or capacity that enables human beings to perform their actions freely. Lombard’s definition appears to be fairly straightforward, but theorists in the first half of the thirteenth century very much disagreed over how it was to be interpreted. Part of the problem is that Lombard himself did not discuss the meaning of the definition in any great detail. Instead, he went on to discuss the place of liberum arbitrium in a larger theological scheme, addressing such questions as whether God has liberum arbitrium, the status of liberum arbitrium both before and after the Fall, and the effects of grace upon liberum arbitrium.

Although later theologians make note of Lombard’s discussion of these topics, they are far more interested in what he didn’t discuss, that is, the basic definition of liberum arbitrium. In the first half of the thirteenth century, there occurs a lively discussion on how to interpret this definition. As far as the participants in this discussion are concerned, there are four possibilities, and there are texts from this period defending each of these possibilities. To say that liberum arbitrium is a faculty of intellect and will could mean 1) that freedom is a function primarily of the intellect and only secondarily of the will 2) that freedom is a function primarily of the will and only secondarily of the intellect 3) that freedom is equally a function of both intellect and will and 4) that freedom is a function of a third capacity independently of intellect and will but with both cognitive and appetitive abilities. Because the fourth interpretation is the most implausible (and the rarest and possibly for those reasons the most interesting) and because it was held by one of the foremost scholars in the medieval period (Albert the Great), it warrants a further look.

b. Albert the Great

Outside of scholarly circles, Albert the Great is largely a forgotten figure or, at best, is known merely as the teacher of Thomas Aquinas. In the thirteenth century, however, he was in fact one of the most famous and respected scholars of the period. He published a wide variety of writings in philosophy, theology, and especially in what we would call natural science. He wrote a number of commentaries on the works of Aristotle and argued for his importance at a time when many of Aristotle’s texts were banned from study at Europe’s universities. Albert’s theory of action is one of the most distinctive parts of his philosophy and one of the most innovative theories of the Middle Ages.

Albert takes as his starting point Lombard’s definition of liberum arbitrium and argues that it should not be interpreted too narrowly. He describes four distinct stages in the production of free human action. First, the intellect identifies viable alternatives for action from which to choose and makes a judgment about what to do. Secondly, the will develops a preference for one of the alternatives identified by the intellect and inclines toward it. Third, a choice is made between the alternative judged by the intellect and the alternative preferred by the will. The capacity for choice is exercised by a power separate from both intellect and will, which Albert calls liberum arbitrium. Finally, the choice is carried out by the will, which inclines the agent to perform the action chosen by liberum arbitrium.

One might worry that the aforementioned description of action implies that human beings are “at the mercy” of their capacities and so are not in charge of their own actions. This is a mistaken judgment. Albert is aware that it is human beings who think, judge, prefer, choose and finally act. What Albert is attempting to explain is how human beings are capable of engaging in all of these activities. He is providing what we might call a microscopic explanation for what happens at the macroscopic level. This is analogous to, say, the neuroscientist providing an explanation for why someone raises her arm in terms of what is happening on the level of the nerves firing and the muscles contracting. We of course assume that such an explanation does not negate our judgment that the agent has control over whether she moves her arm; it is the same in the case of Albert’s explanation.

Albert argues that this account is compatible with Lombard’s definition of liberum arbitrium. He argues that on his account, liberum arbitrium is a faculty of intellect and will, not because it consists of intellect and will, but because it works with intellect and will. Unless the intellect makes a judgment about what to do, and unless the will inclines toward a particular alternative (whether it be the same or different from the intellect’s judgment), there is no choice made by liberum arbitrium. Intellect and will make possible the activity of liberum arbitrium. Thus, liberum arbitrium is a power of intellect and will, not because it is composed of intellect and will, as one might think, but because it operates on the basis what goes on beforehand in intellect and will.

Recall that the whole purpose of liberum arbitrium was to frame the discussion of human freedom. Liberum arbitrium is a placeholder for whatever it is that enables human beings to act freely. Albert argues that liberum arbitrium must be a power distinct from intellect and will because of certain deficiencies or constraints in both intellect and will. The intellect cannot be the source of human freedom, for it is the power by which human beings cognize the world and come to understand truth. Thus, its judgments are constrained by the way the world is; we are not free to decide what we will and will not believe if we want to have truth as our goal. A reality that is not of our own making intrudes. By and large, that is how we want our intellects to operate. Our success in the world depends upon our being able to make accurate judgments about how the world is and what options are open to us. We will return to this view because it has certain implications for Thomas Aquinas’s account of freedom, which implications John Duns Scotus explicitly draws on in his criticism of Aquinas’s account. But for now, we want to see what use Albert makes of this observation. According to Albert, the constraints found in the intellect make it the case that the intellect cannot be the source of human freedom.

But then neither can the will. Albert notes that what distinguishes the actions of human beings from that of other animals is the human ability to contravene felt desires. To take a medieval example, if a sheep is hungry and spies a lush field of grass, the sheep eats in response to a brute felt desire for food. If the sheep is not hungry, the sheep does not eat even if it is standing in the pasture. What determine the sheep’s activities are the sheep’s desires and appetites over which the sheep has no control. It is different in the human case. A human being can feel hungry but not act on that hunger because she can judge that she has compelling reasons not to eat, say because she is waiting for her blood to be drawn for a fasting glucose level. Thus, she has a choice; she can choose either to eat or not to eat depending upon her reasons for doing one thing over the other. This ability to act on the basis of reasons, which confers freedom of action on human beings, is a cognitive ability. Since the will is an appetitive power, it cannot have this ability. The intellect is a cognitive power but is constrained by the way the world is and so cannot be the source of this ability. Albert concludes therefore that human beings must have a third power that enables them to have this ability, which power he identifies with liberum arbitrium.

4. Individual Theories – the High Middle Ages

a. Thomas Aquinas

Thomas Aquinas developed one of the most elaborate and detailed accounts of action in the Middle Ages. It is a testimony to his account that not only scholars of medieval philosophy but also non-historically oriented philosophers remain interested in the details of his view.

Aquinas’s account is roughly Aristotelian in character. Like Aristotle, Aquinas argues that human beings act for the sake of a particular end that they see as a good. Furthermore, he thinks that all human actions aim (directly or indirectly) at an ultimate end. This ultimate end is the final goal or object that human beings are trying to achieve. Aquinas follows Aristotle in arguing that the ultimate end of human life, that which human beings want most of all, is happiness. But Aquinas parts company with Aristotle in arguing that what in fact makes human beings happy is to know and love God.

Aquinas recognizes that such a definition of happiness is highly controversial. He concedes that not everyone agrees that the ultimate goal of human life is union with God. But he takes it as uncontroversial that all human beings desire happiness regardless of whether they agree with him with respect to what in fact constitutes happiness. Given Aquinas’s theological commitments, it is not surprising that he would think that what in fact will make human beings happy (whether they know it or not) is to be in a relationship with the creator and sustainer of the world.

Aquinas presents a detailed account of what goes on when human beings perform a particular course of action. This account reveals a close interaction between intellect and will in bringing about the action. In considering this account, one must keep in mind that although the description that follows is put in terms of a series of steps, these steps have only logical priority and not necessarily temporal priority. For example, Aquinas cites deliberation and choice as distinct steps, but he is willing to grant that one might not spend time deliberating over what to do. One might simply recognize what the situation calls for and choose to do it. In that case, the judgment or recognition of what to do and the choice come about simultaneously. However, Aquinas would insist that the judgment has logical priority insofar as one cannot choose what one is not at least on some level (and perhaps very quickly) cognizant of.

In bringing about a human action, first, human beings have some goal or end in mind when they think about what to do. Without that goal or end, they would in fact never act. Human beings don’t act for the sake of acting; there is always something they are trying to achieve by their actions. In other words, human behavior is always motivated. So human beings think about what they want to accomplish and settle upon a goal. This they do in virtue of their intellects in light of their fundamental desire for the good, which is built into the will. Next they feel an attraction or desire for that goal or end; their will inclines them toward it. Then they begin to think about how to achieve this goal or end; that is to say, they engage in the activity of deliberation. They then make a final judgment about what to do and choose what to do on the basis of that judgment. Aquinas argues that choice is a function of the will in light of a judgment by the intellect. In other words, the will moves the agent towards a particular action, an action that has been determined by the intellect. The will then moves the appropriate limbs of the bodies at the command of the intellect, thus executing the action. Finally, human beings feel enjoyment at their accomplishment or achievement of the end in virtue of the will.

Another aspect of human nature influences human action, and that is what Aquinas calls the passions. Passions are somewhat akin to our conception of emotions. That is, they are felt motivational states such as anger or joy that can have either a positive or a negative effect upon what we do. For example, fear and love for a child can move an otherwise timid individual to push the child out of the way of a speeding car. On the other hand, anger can move an otherwise peaceful person to road rage. Nevertheless, on Aquinas’s account, even though passions are very powerful influences upon actions and can make things appear to us as good that ordinarily would not seem good, the passions cannot simply overwhelm a (properly functioning) intellect and will and thereby determine what we do. Aquinas argues that it is always possible for us to step back and consider whether we should act on our passion as long as we possess a functional intellect and will. It might be difficult to do, since passions can be very strong, but it is always open to us to do so.

This of course is a very brief and succinct description of an account to which Aquinas devotes a significant portion of his texts. What it illustrates though is the complexity of what goes on in the course of producing an action and the ways in which the intellect and will interact with each other in producing a human action. We of course are not necessarily conscious of all of this activity, but Aquinas’s account does not depend upon our being so. He relies on the principle that if a human being is able to do something, there must be some power or capacity that enables her to do so. He then considers what goes on in the course of human action and postulates the kinds of powers or capacities that he thinks human beings must have in order to account for what goes on. So while from a strictly empirical or even scientific viewpoint, Aquinas’s account might seem rather quaint, still from a heuristic perspective, Aquinas’s account remains quite powerful.

One of the ways in which its power is revealed is in Aquinas’s account of good and bad action. He uses his basic framework for action to set up the account. Recall that action is ultimately a function of intellect and will with the potential influence of the passions. Bad action for Aquinas comes about in light of a breakdown of one of these capacities. Because the intellect has to do with knowledge and judgment, sins of the intellect have to do with mistakes in judgment due to ignorance (that is, a lack of knowledge). Aquinas also recognizes that wrongdoing can come about under the influence of passion. Although on his view, the passions are not able to overwhelm a properly functioning intellect and will, still the intellect can give in to passion under inappropriate circumstances (road rage is an obvious example). And finally, because the will is a type of (rational) desire, sins due to the will arise when one’s desire for the good is disordered, leading one to prefer a lesser good, forsaking a greater good that ought to be preferred.

For an action to count as a good action, it must satisfy several conditions. First, it must be a morally acceptable type of action. For Aquinas, such acts as murder, lying, stealing, or adultery are never right, regardless of, say, the circumstances or the end. They are in themselves disordered acts insofar as they, by their very nature, do not promote human flourishing. Secondly, the action must be performed for an appropriate end. Ordinarily, alms-giving is a good act, but it would be a bad action if one were to give alms for the sake of vainglory. And finally the act must be performed in the appropriate circumstances. Ordinarily one would be praised for taking a walk in order to maintain one’s health, but not if there is a blizzard raging outside. Under ordinary conditions (for example, no one’s life is at risk), it would be more appropriate under those circumstances to skip the walk.

For Aquinas, although some acts might be morally neutral in nature (that is, neither promoting nor detracting from human flourishing by their nature), because there are no neutral ends or circumstances, in the final analysis, no actually performed actions are truly morally neutral. Ends are either good or bad for Aquinas. Circumstances are either appropriate or not. Thus, for Aquinas, the range of actions that are candidates for moral appraisal is much broader than one often supposes. Even actions ordinarily considered rather innocuous, such as eating a candy bar or raking leaves, have moral significance for Aquinas.

Finally, although Aquinas is not a utilitarian, he does think that consequences can have an effect on the moral appraisal of an action. What matters is whether the consequences that result from performing the action are the typical consequences associated with an action of that type and whether the agent was in a position to know this. If the agent could have foreseen those consequences, then bad consequences increase the agent’s blameworthiness and good consequences increase the agent’s praiseworthiness. If the agent could not have foreseen such consequences, then they have no effect on the moral appraisal of the action.

Aquinas is interested not only in how human action comes about, but also in what enables human beings to act freely. Given his emphasis on the intellect in his account of action, it is not surprising to find Aquinas arguing that the intellect plays the larger role in the explanation of freedom. This is in contrast with the tradition he inherits, which, as we have seen so far, places the emphasis on the will in the majority of theories. For Aquinas, the fact that the intellect is able to deliberate, consider, and reconsider reasons for choosing various courses of action open to the agent enables the agent to act freely. The will is free but only insofar as the intellect is free to make or revise its judgments. Had the agent decided differently than she did, she would have chosen differently. Thus, freedom in the will is dependent upon and derivative upon freedom in the intellect. As we shall see, this position raises certain potential worries for Aquinas.

b. John Duns Scotus

John Duns Scotus was born in the town of Duns near the English-Scottish boarder sometime in the 1260s. Educated both in England and at the University of Paris, he died in Cologne, Germany in 1308. Known for the complexity of his thought, he was referred to in the Middle Ages as the Subtle Doctor.

Scotus argues that if Aquinas is correct, human beings do not act freely. This is because in Scotus’s view, the intellect is determined by the external environment, a position we saw earlier in Albert the Great. Scotus argues that the content of our beliefs and judgments is a function of the world around us and not within our control. If I see a table in front of me and I am functioning normally, I cannot help but believe that there is a table in front of me. I have some control over my beliefs; I can choose to acquire beliefs about quantum mechanics that I did not have before simply by choosing to read a book on the subject. I can take the table out of the room so that I no longer believe that there is a table in front of me. But even here my beliefs are fixed once I finish my manipulations of the world; ultimately then, I have no control over their content. Once I read the book, I have beliefs based upon what I have read and I am not in a position to alter their content unless I read something further. Once I move the table, the world as it exists at that point structures my belief about the table. As we mentioned before, this is how we want the world and our beliefs to function. If we could not arrive at beliefs that accurately reflected the state of the world around us, we would not survive. Scotus argues that this feature of our beliefs and their relationship to the world means that the intellect is not free. Thus, if Aquinas is correct that the movement of the will is determined by activity in the intellect, then if it is true that the intellect is not free, the will is not free either, and human beings would not act freely.

Scotus denies Aquinas’s tight connection between the intellect and the will, arguing that the will is not determined by a judgment of the intellect, a position we first noted in Bernard of Clairvaux. Scotus draws upon our ordinary experience to defend this claim. We have all been in situations where we know what we ought to do and yet we are not moved to do it. The student knows she ought to study for her exams, but she is so comfortable lying on the couch that she does not get up to study. She will get up to study only insofar as she really wants to do so, and no judgment will move her to do so in opposition to her desire. Scotus describes this kind of case as one in which the will, the source of her desire to remain on the couch, wills (or in this case fails to will) in opposition to the judgment of the intellect. Thus, the will is free of determination by the intellect.

Scotus agrees with Aquinas that the will depends upon the intellect to identify possible courses of action from which the will chooses, but he rejects Aquinas’s view that the intellect’s judgment determines the will’s choice. For Scotus, the intellect makes a judgment about what to do, but it is up to the will to determine which alternative–out of all those the intellect has identified as possibilities–the agent acts upon. Scotus also agrees with Aquinas that human beings cannot will misery for its own sake, but he denies that this implies that human beings are necessitated to choose happiness. On Scotus’s account, human beings choose happiness if they choose anything at all and they cannot will against happiness, but they nevertheless can fail to will happiness.

5. Conclusion

Thinkers throughout the Middle Ages found the topics of action and free will compelling for many of the same reasons why they remain of perennial interest today. Philosophers find them interesting in their own right as well as recognizing their implications for moral responsibility, the concept of personhood, and such important religious issues as the problem of evil and the tension with divine omniscience. The general character of many medieval theories of free will is voluntarist in nature, with the views of Albert the Great and Thomas Aquinas the most significant departures from this trend.

The accounts of Thomas Aquinas and of John Duns Scotus are useful paradigms to illustrate some of the advantages and disadvantages of voluntarist and intellectualist approaches to action and its freedom. We have seen that the determinant nature of our beliefs raises a problem for Aquinas’s location of freedom in the intellect. Aquinas also has a harder time explaining cases of weakness of will (that is, cases where an agent recognizes the better choice but chooses the lesser one). These cases are tough for Aquinas to explain because they seem to involve a judgment that a particular action is the better thing to do, yet the agent chooses not to perform that action. Instead, the agent chooses some other action that the agent is willing to grant is worse. Scotus has a much easier time accommodating these cases, since for him, the will is never necessitated by a judgment of intellect. Yet his theory faces an important objection: the arbitrariness objection. Because there is no tight connection between intellect and will on Scotus’s account, the will is never determined by the judgment of intellect. Therefore, it is always possible for the will either to will in accordance with the intellect’s judgment or against it. This situation raises the question: why does the agent choose as she does? It can’t be because the intellect made a particular judgment, for the will is not determined by that judgment. Scotus argues that there is no further explanation for the will’s choice; the will simply chooses. But then the will’s choice and the agent’s subsequent action become very mysterious. Thus, Scotus loses a rational grounding for understanding why an agent acts as she does. He can no longer appeal to an agent’s reasons for acting one way rather than another, for those reasons do not determine the agent’s choice. Because Aquinas maintains a tight connection between the intellect’s judgment and the will’s choice, he does not face this particular objection and can maintain what is known as a reasons-explanation for action. In the end, what is an advantage for the one theory becomes a difficulty for the other, and vice versa.

See also the article Foreknowledge and Free Will in this encyclopedia.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Albert the Great. Opera Omnia. Augustus Borgnet, ed., Paris: Vives, 1890-9.
    • Unfortunately, the works of Albert the Great are not yet widely available in translation.
  • Albert the Great. Opera Omnia. Bernhard Geyer et al, eds. Bonn: Institum Alerti Magni, 1951-.
    • A newer and currently incomplete edition of Albert’s works.
  • Anselm of Canterbury. Three Philosophical Dialogues. Thomas Williams, trans. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., 2002.
    • This book includes Anselm’s treatises, On Freedom of Choice and On the Fall of the Devil.
  • Anselm of Canterbury. Truth, Freedom, and Evil. Jasper Hopkins and Herbert Richardson, trans. New York: Harper and Row, 1965.
    • This book includes Anselm’s treatises, On Freedom of Choice and On the Fall of the Devil.
  • Aquinas, Thomas. Summa theologiae. Fathers of the English Dominican Province, trans. Allen, TX: Christian Classics, 1981 (reprint).
  • Aquinas, Thomas. Treatise on Happiness. John A. Oesterle, trans. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1964.
    • This book consists of the twenty-one questions from Summa theologiae that have to do with the human ultimate end, and human action and its freedom.
  • Augustine. On Free Choice of the Will. Thomas Williams, trans. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., 1993.
  • Bernard of Clairvaux. On Grace and Free Choice. Daniel O’Donovan, trans. Kalamazoo, MI: Cistercian Publications, Inc., 1988.
  • Lombard, Peter. Sententiae in IV libris distinctae. Ignatius Brady, ed. Grottoferrata: Editiones Colegii S.Bonaventurae ad Claras Aquas, 1971-81.
  • Lombard, Peter. The Sentences Book 2: On Creation. Mediaeval Sources in Translation. Giulio Silano,trans. Toronto: PIMS, 2008.
    • The question on liberum arbitrium is found in book two, distinction 24.
  • Scotus, John Duns. Duns Scotus on the Will and Morality. Allan B. Wolter, O.F.M., trans. William A Frank, ed. Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 1997.
    • This is a reprint of an earlier (1986) edition in which the Latin text found in the 1986 edition has been removed. In addition to primary texts, it contains commentary by Wolter.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Alexander, Archibald. Theories of the Will in the History of Philosophy. New York: Scribner, 1898.
  • Bourke, Vernon J. Will in Western Thought. New York: Sheed and Ward, 1964.
  • Chappell, T.D.J. Aristotle and Augustine on Freedom: Two Theories of Freedom Voluntary Action, and Akrasia. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1995.
  • Colish, Marcia. Peter Lombard. Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1994.
  • Davies, Brian, ed. Aquinas’s Summa Theologiae: Critical Essays. Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 2006.
    • Contains some essays on action and freedom.
  • Matthews, Gareth B., ed. The Augustinian Tradition. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1999.
    • A collection of essays on Augustine, some of which deal with his theory of will and freedom.
  • Matthews, Gareth B. Augustine. Blackwell Publishing, 2005.
  • McCluskey, Colleen. “Intellective Appetite and the Freedom of Human Action.” The Thomist 66 (2002): 421-56.
    • A defense of Aquinas’s theory of freedom against criticisms raised by Thomas Williams in the article listed below from The Thomist.
  • McCluskey, Colleen. “Worthy Constraints in Albertus Magnus’s Theory of Action.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 39 (2001):491-533.
  • MacDonald, Scott, and Stump, Eleonore, eds. Aquinas’s Moral Theory: Essays in Honor of Norman Kretzmann. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1999.
    • This book includes essays on Aquinas’s theory of the passions as well as his account of practical reasoning.
  • Pope, Stephen J., ed. The Ethics of Aquinas. Washington, DC: Georgetown University Press, 2002.
    • This book contains essays on Aquinas’s theory of action and freedom as well as his ethics. It is organized around the specific questions in Summa theologiae that deal with these issues.
  • Rogers, Katherin. “Anselm on Grace and Free Will.” The Saint Anselm Journal 2 (2005): 66-72.
  • Stump, Eleonore. Aquinas. London: Routledge, 2003.
    • A broad discussion of Aquinas’s views, including his theory of action and freedom.
  • Westberg, Daniel. Right Practical Reason: Aristotle, Action, and Prudence in Aquinas. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1994.
  • Williams, Thomas and Visser, Sandra. “Anselm’s Account of Freedom.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 31 (2001): 221-244.
  • Williams, Thomas. “The Libertarian Foundations of Scotus’s Moral Philosophy.” The Thomist (1998): 193-215.
    • This article also contains a criticism of Aquinas’s theory of freedom.
  • Williams, Thomas. “How Scotus Separates Morality from Happiness.” American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 69 (1995): 425-445.

Author Information

Colleen McClusky
Email: mcclusc@slu.edu
Saint Louis University
U. S. A.

Anaxagoras (c.500—428 B.C.E.)

AnaxagorasAnaxagoras of Clazomenae was an important Presocratic natural philosopher and scientist who lived and taught in Athens for approximately thirty years. He gained notoriety for his materialistic views, particularly his contention that the sun was a fiery rock. This led to charges of impiety, and he was sentenced to death by the Athenian court. He avoided this penalty by leaving Athens, and he spent his remaining years in exile. Although Anaxagoras proposed theories on a variety of subjects, he is most noted for two theories. First, he speculated that in the physical world everything contains a portion of everything else. His observation of how nutrition works in animals led him to conclude that in order for the food an animal eats to turn into bone, hair, flesh, and so forth, it must already contain all of those constituents within it. The second theory of significance is Anaxagoras’ postulation of Mind (Nous) as the initiating and governing principle of the cosmos.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Writing
  2. The Structure of Things: A Portion of Everything in Everything
    1. The Challenge of Parmenides
    2. Empedocles’s Theory
    3. The Lesson of Nutrition
    4. The Divisibility of “Stuffs”
    5. Why is Something What It Is?
  3. The Origins of the Cosmos
  4. Mind (Nous)
    1. The Role of Mind
    2. The Nature of Mind
  5. Other Theories
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Writing

The exact chronology of Anaxagoras is unknown, but most accounts place his dates around 500-428 B.C.E. Some have argued for dates of c.534-467 B.C.E., but the 500-428 time period is the most commonly accepted among scholars. Anaxagoras was born in Ionia in the town of Clazomenae, a lively port city on the coast of present-day Turkey. As such, he is considered to be both the geographical and theoretical successor to the earliest Ionian philosophers, particularly Anaximenes. Eventually, Anaxagoras made his way to Athens and he is often credited with making her the home of Western philosophical and physical speculation. Anaxagoras remained in Athens for some thirty years, according to most accounts, until he was indicted on the charge of impiety and sentenced to death. Rather than endure this penalty, Anaxagoras, with the help of his close friend and student, Pericles, went to Lampsacus in Asia Minor where he lived until his death.

Anaxagoras’ trial and sentencing in Athens were motivated by a combination of political and religious concerns. His close association with Pericles left him vulnerable to those who wished to discredit the powerful and controversial student through the teacher. Furthermore, his materialistic beliefs and teachings were quite contrary to the standard orthodoxy of the time, particularly his view that the heavenly bodies were fiery masses of rock whirling around the earth in ether. Such convictions are famously attested to in Plato’s Apology when Socrates, accused by Meletus of believing that the sun is stone and the moon is earth, distances himself from such atheistic notions:

My dear Meletus, do you think you are prosecuting Anaxagoras? Are you so contemptuous of the jury and think them so ignorant of letters as not to know that the books of Anaxagoras of Clazomenae are full of those theories, and further, that the young men learn from me what they can buy from time to time for a drachma, at most, in the bookshops, and ridicule Socrates if he pretends that these theories are his own, especially as they are so absurd? (26d)

As with the dates of his birth and death, the chronology of Anaxagoras’ exile and subsequent time in Lampsacus are a bit of a mystery. Some of the historical testimonies indicate that his trial occurred shortly before the Peloponnesian War, around 431 B.C.E. If this is the case, then Anaxagoras’ time in exile would have lasted no more than a few years. Other records indicate that his trial and exile occurred much earlier, and his time in Lampsacus enabled him to start an influential school where he taught for nearly twenty years. With regard to the persona of Anaxagoras, there are quite a few interesting anecdotes that paint a picture of an ivory tower scientist and philosopher who was extremely detached from the general concerns and practical matters of life. While the stories are possibly fanciful, the consistent image of Anaxagoras presented throughout antiquity is that of a person entirely consumed by the pursuit of knowledge. In fact, he apparently maintained that the opportunity to study the universe was the fundamental reason why it is better to be born than to not exist.

In his Lives of the Philosophers, Diogenes Laertius states that Anaxagoras is among those philosophers who wrote only one book. This work was a treatise on natural philosophy and, as the above quote from the Apology indicates, it was probably not a very long work, since it could be purchased for “a drachma, at most.” Although the book has not survived, it was available until at least the sixth-century CE. While it is impossible to recreate the entire content and order of his work, various ancient sources have provided scholars with enough information to fairly represent Anaxagoras’ philosophy. Noteworthy among these sources are Aristotle, Theophrastus (ca.372-288 B.C.E.), and Themistius (c.317-387 C.E.). We are primarily indebted, however, to Simplicius (sixth-century C.E.) for most of our knowledge of, and access to, the fragments of Anaxagoras’ work. Before moving on to the theories of Anaxagoras, note that there are some rather wide-ranging disagreements among contemporary scholars about some of the basic tenets of his philosophy. In the first-quarter of the 21st century, there have been a greater variety of interpretations of Anaxagoras than of any other Presocratic philosopher.

2. The Structure of Things: A Portion of Everything in Everything

Anaxagoras’ innovative theory of physical nature is encapsulated in the phrase, “a portion of everything in everything.” Its primary expression is found in the following difficult fragment:

And since the portions of both the large and the small are equal in amount, in this way too all things would be in everything; nor can they be separate, but all things have a portion of everything. Since there cannot be a smallest, nothing can be separated or come to be by itself, but as in the beginning now too all things are together. But in all things there are many things, equal in amount, both in the larger and the smaller of the things being separated off. (frag. 6)

It should be pointed out that it is rather difficult to determine what exactly Anaxagoras meant by “things.” It is tempting to view this as a theory of matter, but this would be misguided as it tends to apply later Aristotelian categories and interpretations onto Anaxagoras. At times, the term “seeds” has been utilized but it would seem that many scholars today prefer the neutral term “stuffs” to depict this notion. In any case, this rather complex theory is best understood as Anaxagoras’ attempt to reconcile his perceptions of the world with an influential argument (presented some time earlier by Parmenides) about how reality must be conceived.

a. The Challenge of Parmenides

According to Parmenides, whatever is, is (being) and whatever is not, is not (nonbeing). As a result, whatever constitutes the nature of reality must always “have been” since nothing can come into being from nothing. Furthermore, reality must always “be” since being (what is) cannot become nonbeing (what is not). This argument led Parmenides to a monistic and static conception of reality. As such, the world of changing particulars is deceptive, despite appearances to the contrary. Anaxagoras appears to accept this argument of Parmenides as the following statement indicates: “The Greeks are wrong to accept coming to be and perishing, for no thing comes to be, nor does it perish.” (frag. 17) Anaxagoras could not, however, square the thesis of radical monism with his experience of a world that seems to admit plurality and change. In fact, if all of the theses of Parmenides are correct, there is no possibility of science because all empirically gathered data is misleading. Therefore, the challenge for Anaxagoras and other post-Parmenidian philosophers was to present a proper account of nature while maintaining the demand that the stuff that constitutes reality can neither come into being from nothing nor pass away into nonbeing.

b. Empedocles’s Theory

Empedocles was a contemporary of Anaxagoras and, while the historical records are inconclusive, it is possible that the latter was partially reacting to the theory of the former in the development of his own views. In response to Parmenides, Empedocles maintained that the four elements—earth, air, fire, water—were the constituents or “roots” of all matter. These four roots cannot come into being, be destroyed or admit any change. Therefore, apart from the fact that there are four, they are essentially identical to the “one” of Parmenides. The roots mix together in various proportions to account for all the things in the world that we suppose to be real, such as apples, horses, etc. As an apple dissolves, it does not collapse into nonbeing, rather the mixture that has accounted for the apparent apple of our senses has simply been rearranged. Apples, and other “mortal things,” as Empedocles called them, do not actually come to be, nor are they actually destroyed. This is simply the way humans like to talk about entities which appear to exist but do not.

Anaxagoras’ relationship to Empedocles is difficult to discern, but it is possible that he was not satisfied with Empedocles’ response to Parmenides and the Eliatics. On Aristotle’s interpretation, Anaxagoras maintained that the pluralism of Empedocles unduly singled out certain substances as primary and others as secondary. According to Anaxagoras, the testimony of our senses maintains that hair or flesh exist as assuredly as earth, air, water or fire. In fact, all of the infinite numbers of substances are as real as the root substances. Therefore, under this interpretation the key problem for Anaxagoras is that under Empodocles’ theory it would be possible to divide a hair into smaller and smaller pieces until it was no longer hair, but a composite of the root substances. As such, this would no longer satisfy the requirement that a definite substance cannot pass into nonbeing. According to other interpretations, however, some of the textual evidence from Anaxagoras seems to suggest that he treated some “things” (ala Empedocles) as more basic and primary than others. In any case, the theoretical distinctions between the two philosophers are somewhat unclear. Despite these difficulties, it is clear that Anaxagoras proposes a theory of things that is distinct from Empedocles while encountering the challenges of Parmenides.

c. The Lesson of Nutrition

While there is some recent scholarly debate about this, Anaxagoras’ contention that all things have a portion of everything may have had its genesis in the phenomenon of nutrition. He observed among animals that the food that is used to nourish develops into flesh, hair, etc. For this to be the case, Anaxagoras believed that rice, for instance, must contain within it the substances hair and flesh. Again, this is in keeping with the notion that definite substances cannot arise from nothing: “For how can hair come to be from not hair or flesh from not flesh?” (frag. 10). Moreover, not only does a piece of rice contain hair and flesh, it in fact contains the entirety of all the infinite amount of stuffs (a portion of everything). But how is this possible?

d. The Divisibility of “Stuffs”

To understand how it is possible for there to be a portion of everything in everything, it is necessary to develop Anaxagoras’ contention that stuff is infinitely divisible. In practical terms, this can be explained by continuing with the example of the rice kernel. For Anaxagoras, if one were to begin dividing it into smaller and smaller portions there would be no point at which the rice would no longer exist. Each infinitesimally small piece could be divided into another, and each piece would continue to contain rice, as well as hair, flesh and a portion of everything else. Prior to Anaxagoras, Zeno, a disciple of Parmenides, argued against the notion that matter could be divided at all, let alone infinitely. Apparently, Zeno had about forty reductio ad absurdum attacks on pluralism, four of which are known to us. For our purposes, it is not necessary to delve into these arguments, but a key assumption that arises from Zeno is the contention that a plurality of things would make the notion of magnitude meaningless. For Zeno, if an infinite division of things were possible then the following paradox would arise. The divisions would conceivably be so small that they would have no magnitude at all. At the same time, things would have to be considered infinitely large in order to be able to be infinitely divided. While the scholarly evidence is not conclusive, it seems quite possible that Anaxagoras was replying to Zeno as he developed his notion of infinite divisibility.

As the following fragment indicates, Anaxagoras did not consider the consequence that Zeno presented to be problematic: “For of the small there is no smallest, but always a smaller (for what is cannot not be). But also of the large there is always a larger, and it is equal in amount to the small. But in relation to itself, each is both large and small” (frag. 3). According to some interpreters, what is remarkable about this fragment, and others similar to it, is that it indicates the extent to which Anaxagoras grasped the notion of infinity. As W.K.C. Guthrie points out, “Anaxagoras’ reply shows an understanding of the meaning of infinity which no Greek before him had attained: things are indeed infinite in quantity and at the same time infinitely small, but they can go on becoming smaller to infinity without thereby becoming mere points without magnitude” (289). Other interpretations are somewhat less charitable toward Anaxagoras’ grasp of infinity, however, and point out that he may not have been conceptualizing about the notion of mathematical infinity when speaking about divisibility.

In any case, as strange as it may appear to modern eyes, Anaxagoras’ unique and subtle theory accomplished what it set out to do. It satisfied the Parmenidian demand that nothing can come into or out of being and it accounted for the plurality and change that constitutes our world of experience. A difficult question remains for Anaxagoras’ theory, however.

e. Why is Something What It Is?

If, according to Anaxagoras, everything contains a portion of everything, then what makes something (rice, for instance) what it is? Anaxagoras does not provide a clear response to this question, but an answer is alluded to in his claim that “each single thing is and was most plainly those things of which it contains most.” (frag. 12) Presumably, this can be taken to mean that each constituent of matter also has a part of matter that is predominant in it. Commentators from Aristotle onward have struggled to make sense of this notion, but it is perhaps Guthrie’s interpretation that is most helpful: “Everything contains a portion of everything else, and a large piece of something contains as many portions as a small piece of it, though they differ in size; but every substance does not contain all the infinite number of substances in equal proportions” (291). As such, a substance like rice, while containing everything, contains a higher proportion of white, hardness, etc. than a substance like wood. Simply stated, rice contains more stuff that makes it rice than wood or any other substance. Presumably, rice also contains higher proportions of flesh and hair than wood does. This would explain why, from Anaxagoras’ perspective, an animal can become nourished by rice by not by wood.

Anaxagoras’ theory of nature is quite innovative and complex, but unfortunately his fragments do not provide us with very many details as to how things work on a micro level. He does, however, provide us with a macro level explanation for the origins of the world as we experience it. It is to his cosmogony that we now turn our attention.

3. The Origins of the Cosmos

Anaxagoras’ theory of the origins of the world is reminiscent of the cosmogonies that had been previously developed in the Ionion tradition, particularly through Anaximenes and Anaximander. The traditional theories generally depict an original unity which begins to become separated off into a series of opposites. Anaxagoras maintained many of the key elements of these theories, however he also updated these cosmogonies, most notably through the introduction of a causal agent (Mind or nous) that is the initiator of the origination process.

Prior to the beginning of world as we know it everything was combined together in such a unified manner that there were no qualities or individual substances that could be discerned. “All things were together, unlimited in both amount and smallness.” (frag. 1) As such, reality was like the Parmenidian whole, except this whole contained all the primary matters or “seeds,” which are represented in the following passages through a series of opposites:

But before these things separated off, when [or, since] all things were together, not even any color was manifest, for the mixture of all things prevented it—the wet and the dry, the hot and the cold, the bright and the dark, there being also much earth in the mixture and seeds unlimited in amount, in no way like one another. For none of the other things are alike either, the one to the other. Since this is so, it is necessary to suppose that all things were in the whole. (frag. 4b) The things in the single cosmos are not separate from one another, nor are they split apart with an axe, either the hot from the cold or the cold from the hot (frag. 8).

At some point, the unity is spurred into a vortex motion at a force and a speed “of nothing now found among humans, but altogether many times as fast” (frag. 9). This motion begins the separation and it is “air and aither” that are the first constituents of matter to become distinct. Again, this is not to be seen in Empedoclean terms to indicate that air and ether are primary elements They are simply a part of the infinite constituents of matter represented by the phrase “mixture and seeds.” As the air and ether became separated off, all other elements become manifest in this mixture as well: “From these things as they are being separated off, earth is being compounded; for water is being separated off out of the clouds, earth out of water, and out of the earthy stones are being compounded by the cold, and these [i.e., stones] move further out than the water” (frag. 16).

Therefore, the origin of the world is depicted through this process of motion and separation from the unified mixture. As mentioned above, in answering the “how” of cosmogony, Anaxagoras is fairly traditional in his theory. In proposing an initiator or causal explanation for the origins of the process, however, Anaxagoras separates himself from his predecessors.

4. Mind (Nous)

a. The Role of Mind

According to Anaxagoras, the agent responsible for the rotation and separation of the primordial mixture is Mind or nous: “And when Mind began to cause motion, separating off proceeded to occur from all that was moved, and all that Mind moved was separated apart, and as things were being moved and separated apart, the rotation caused much more separating apart to occur” (fr. 13). As is previously mentioned, it is rather significant that Anaxagoras postulates an explanation for the movement of the cosmos, something that prior cosmogonies did not provide. But how is this explanation to be understood? From the passage above, one may infer that Mind serves simply as the initial cause for the motion, and once the rotation is occurring, the momentum sets everything else into place. In this instance it is tempting to assign a rather deistic function to Mind. In other passages, however, Mind is depicted as “ruling” the rotation and setting everything in order as well as having supreme power and knowledge of all things (see fr. 12 and Simplicius’ Commentary on Aristotle’s Physics, 495.20). In this case it is tempting to characterize Mind in theistic terms. Both of these temptations should be avoided, for Anaxagoras remained fully naturalistic in his philosophy. In fact, the uniqueness of Anaxagoras is that he proposed a rationalistic governing principle that remained free from the mythical or theological characteristics of prior cosmogonies. His philosophical successors, particularly Socrates, Plato and Aristotle, are very excited to find in Anaxagoras a unifying cosmic principle which does not allude to the whims of the gods. They hope to find in him an extension of this principle into a purpose-driven explanation for the universe. Alas, they are all disappointed that Anaxagoras makes no attempt to develop his theory of Mind in such a way.

What Socrates, Plato and Aristotle were hoping to discover in Anaxagoras was not simply an account of how the cosmos originated (an efficient cause), but an explanation for why and for what purpose the cosmos was initiated (a final cause). Their initial excitement about his theory is replaced by disillusionment in the fact that Anaxagoras does not venture beyond mechanistic explanatory principles and offer an account for how Mind has ordered everything for the best. For example, in the Phaedo, Socrates discusses how he followed Anaxagoras’ argument with great joy, and thought that he had found, “a teacher about the cause of things after my own heart” (97d). Socrates’ joy is rather short-lived: “This wonderful hope was dashed as I went on reading and saw that the man made no use of Mind, nor gave it any responsibility for the management of things, but mentioned as causes air and ether and water and many other strange things” (98b). Similarly, Aristotle calls Anaxagoras a sober and original thinker, yet chastises him for using Mind as a deus ex machina to account for the creation of the world: “When he cannot explain why something is necessarily as it is, he drags in Mind, but otherwise hew will use anything rather than Mind to explain a particular phenomenon” (Metaphysics, 985a18). Despite the fact that Anaxagoras did not pursue matters as far as his teleologically-minded successors would have liked, his theory of Mind served as an impetus toward the development of cosmological systems that speculated on final causes. On the flip side, Anaxagoras’ lack of conjecture into the non-mechanistic forces in the world also served as an inspiration to the more materialistic cosmological systems that followed.

b. The Nature of Mind

Thus far, we have examined the role of Mind in the development of the world. But what exactly is Mind, according to Anaxagoras? Based on the evidence in the fragments, this is a rather difficult question to answer, for Mind appears to have contradictory properties. In one small fragment, for example, Anaxagoras claims that mind is the sole exception to the principle that there is a portion of everything in everything, yet this claim is immediately followed by the counter claim, “but Mind is in some things too” (frag. 11). Elsewhere, Anaxagoras emphasizes the autonomy and separateness of Mind:

The rest have a portion of everything, but Mind is unlimited and self-ruled and is mixed with no thing, but is alone and by itself. For if it were not by itself but were mixed with something else, it would have a share of all things, if it were mixed with anything. For in everything there is a portion of everything, as I have said before. And the things mixed together with it would hinder it so that it would rule no thing in the same way as it does being alone and by itself. For it is the finest of all things and the purest, and it has all judgment about everything and the greatest power. (frag. 12)

He goes on to say, however, that Mind “is very much even now where all other things are too, in the surrounding multitude and in things that have come together in the process of separating and in things that have separated off” (frag. 14).

Most commentators maintain that Anaxagoras is committed to a dualism of some sort with his theory of Mind. But his Mind/matter dualism is such that both constituents appear to be corporeal in nature. Mind is material, but it is distinguished from the rest of matter in that it is finer, purer and it appears to act freely. This theory is best understood by considering Anaxagoras’ contention that plants possess minds. It is the mind of a plant which enables it to seek nourishment and grow, but this dynamic agent in a plant is not distinct from the plant itself. This would have been a common biological view for the time, but where Anaxagoras is novel is that he extends the workings of “mind” at the level of plants and animals into a cosmic principle which governs all things. The Mind of the cosmos is a dynamic governing principle which is immanent to the entire natural system while still maintaining its transcendental determining power. From Anaxagoras’ perspective it appears to be a principle which is both natural and divine.

5. Other Theories

Anaxagoras’ theory of things and his postulation of Mind as a cosmic principle are the most important and unique aspects of his philosophy. A few other theories are worth mentioning, though it should be pointed out that many of them are probably not original and our primary knowledge of these views arises from second-hand sources.

As a natural scientist and philosopher of his day, Anaxagoras would have been particularly concerned with the subjects of astronomy and meteorology and he made some significant contributions in these areas. It was mentioned above that his outlook on the heavenly bodies played a part in his condemnation in Athens. His beliefs about the earth, moon and sun are clearly articulated in the following lengthy quote from Hippolytus, a source from the late second century CE:

The earth [according to Anaxagoras] is flat in shape. It stays up because of its size, because there is no void, and because the air, which is very resistant, supports the earth, which rests on it. Now we turn to the liquids on the earth: The sea existed all along, but the water in it became the way it is because it suffered evaporation, and it is also added to from the rivers which flow into it. Rivers originate from rains and also from subterranean water; for the earth is hollow and has water in its hollows. The Nile rises in the summer because water is carried down into it from the snow in the north.The sun, the moon, and all the heavenly bodies are red-hot stones which have been snatched up by the rotation of the aether. Below the heavenly bodies there exist certain bodies which revolve along with the sun and the moon and are invisible….The moon is below the sun, closer to us. The sun is larger than the Peloponnesus. The moon does not shine with its own light, but receives its light from the sun…. Eclipses of the moon occur when the earth cuts off the light, and sometimes when the bodies below the moon cut off the light. Eclipses of the sun take place at new moon, when the moon cuts off the light…. Anaxagoras was the first to describe the circumstances under which eclipses occur and the way light is reflected by the moon. He said that the moon is made of earth and has plains and gullies on it. The Milky Way is the light of those stars which are not lit up by the sun. (A Refutation of All Heresies, 1, epitome, 3)

A key advantage of Anaxagoras’ belief that the heavenly bodies were simply stone masses was that it enabled him to provide an account of meteorites as bodies that occasionally become dislodged from the cosmic vortex and plummet to earth. Plutarch attests that Anaxagoras was credited with predicting the fall of a meteorite in 467 B.C.E, but it is unclear from the historical attestations whether Anaxagoras’ theory predated or was prompted by the event.

Along with his contributions in Astronomy and Meteorology, Anaxagoras proposed a theory of sensation that works on the principle of difference. The assumption behind Anaxagoras’ theory is that there is some sort of qualitative change that occurs with any sensation or perception. When a cold hand touches a hot object the agent will only experience the sensation of heat because her hand is cold and the hot object has brought about some sort of change. Therefore, in order for this change (the sensation) to occur, it is necessary that unlike things interact with each other, i.e., hot with cold, light with dark. If like things interact—hot with hot, for example—then no change occurs and there is no sensation. Perception works the same way as our sense of touch. Humans are able to see better during the daytime because our eyes are generally dark. Furthermore, perception works the same way as touch for Anaxagoras in that there is a physical interaction with the perceiver and the object perceived. Since a sensation requires an encounter with an opposite, Anaxagoras also maintained that every sensory act is accompanied by some sort of irritation. As Theophrastus notes, “Anaxagoras comes to this conclusion because bright colors are excessively loud noises are irritating, and it is impossible to bear them very long” (On Sense Perception, 27). Anaxagoras theory of sensation and perception is in direct opposition to Empedocles who maintained that perception could be accounted for by an action between like objects.

A couple of final speculations that are worth mentioning pertain to the science of biology. It has already been noted that Anaxagoras believes plants to have minds along with animals and humans. What places humans in a higher category of intelligence, however, is the fact that we were equipped with hands, for it is through these unique instruments that we are able to handle and manipulate objects. Finally, Anaxagoras proposed an hypothesis on how the sex of an infant is determined. If the sperm comes from the right testicle it will attach itself to the right side of the womb and the baby will be a male. If the sperm comes from the left testicle it will attach itself to the left side of the womb and the baby will be a female.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Barnes, Jonathan. The Presocratic Philosophers. New York, NY: Routledge, 1996.
  • Furley, David. Anaxagoras, “Plato and Naming of Parts.” Presocratic Philosophy. Eds. Victor Caston and Daniel W. Graham. Burlington VT: Ashgate Publishing Limited, 2002. 119-126.
  • Gershenson, Daniel E. and Greenberg, Daniel A. Anaxagoras and the Birth of Physics. New York: Blaisdell Publishing Company, 1964. [It should be pointed out that scholars have been rather critical of this work, but it is a rather helpful reference for sources on Anaxagoras.]
  • Graham, Daniel, “The Postulates of Anaxagoras”, Apeiron 27 (1994), pp.77-121.
  • Guthrie, W.K.C. A History of Greek Philosophy. Vol. 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1965.
  • Kirk, G.S., Raven, J.E. and Schofield, M. The Presocratic Philosophers. 2nd ed. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
  • McKirahan, Richard D. Philosophy Before Socrates. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 1994.
  • Schofield, Malcolm. An Essay on Anaxagoras. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1980.
  • Sider, David. The Fragments of Anaxagoras. 2nd ed. revised. Sankt Augustin: Academia Verlag, 2005
  • Taylor, C.C.W. “Anaxagoras and the Atomists.” From the Beginning to Plato: Routledge History of Philosophy, Vol. I. Ed. C.C.W. Taylor. New York, NY: Routledge, 1997. 208-243.

Author Information

Michael Patzia
Email: michael.patzia@lmu.edu
Central College
U. S. A.

Zhong Hui (Chung Hui, 225–264 C.E.)

Zhong HuiZhong Hui (Chung Hui) was a major philosophical figure during China’s early medieval period (220-589 CE). An accomplished interpreter of the Laozi and the Yijing, Zhong Hui contributed significantly to the early development of xuanxue—literally “learning” (xue) of the “dark” or “mysterious” (xuan) Dao (“Way”), but sometimes translated as “Neo-Daoism“. He also was a major political figure whose ambition eventually led to his untimely demise. Virtually all of Zhong Hui’s writings have been lost, which perhaps explains why he has been given scant attention by students of Chinese philosophy. Had he not failed in his attempt to overthrow the regime of his day, no doubt his writings would have been preserved and given the attention they justly deserve. In particular, his views on human “capacity and nature” (caixing), as developed in his interpretation of the Laozi, are major contributions to xuanxue philosophy, which dominated the Chinese intellectual scene from the third to the sixth century CE. In contrast to other thinkers of the time, who argued that capacity and nature are the same (tong), different (yi), or diverge from one another (li), Zhong Hui argued that they coincide (he). In effect, he proposed that what is endowed is potential, which must be carefully nurtured and brought to completion through learning and effort. While one’s native endowment is not sufficient, one must have some material to begin with in order to achieve the desired result. Thus, it cannot be said that the latter has nothing to do with the former.

Table of  Contents

  1. Philosopher and Statesman
  2. Zhong Hui’s Laozi Learning
    1. The “Nothingness” of Dao
    2. Self-Cultivation, Great Peace, and the Nature of the Sage
  3. The Debate on Capacity and Nature
  4. References and Further Reading

1. Philosopher and Statesman

Toward the end of the second century CE, the once glorious Han dynasty (founded in 206 BCE) was already in irreparable decline, with regional military commanders competing for power and control. Among them, Cao Cao (155–220) proved the strongest and in 220 CE his son, Cao Pi (187–226), formally ended the rule of Han and established the Wei dynasty (220–265).

The third century was a time of profound change. The end of the Han dynasty brought political turmoil and hardship; but it also cleared a space for intellectual renewal. The Confucian tradition that dominated much of the Han intellectual landscape now seemed powerless to overcome the forces of disorder that threatened to tear the country asunder. Indeed, to some scholars Han Confucianism was not only ineffective as a remedy, but also part of the problem that led to the downfall of the Han dynasty. New approaches to reestablishing order were urgently needed. In this context, xuanxue was born.

The word xuan literally depicts a shade of black with dark red. It appears prominently in the Laozi, signifying metaphorically the profound unfathomability of the Dao. For this reason, xuanxue has been translated as “Neo-Daoism.” However, while it is true that third-century Chinese philosophers turned to the Laozi for insight, the term “Neo-Daoism” can be misleading because mainstream xuanxue was never a partisan Daoist or “anti-Confucian” movement. Rather, xuanxue scholars saw the whole classical heritage as embodying the truth of the Dao. In other words, Confucius, Laozi, and other sages and near-sages of old were all concerned with unlocking the mystery of Dao, to lay out a blueprint for order. They were all “Daoists” in this sense. What seemed necessary was a radical reinterpretation of the classical tradition that would eradicate the distortions and excesses of Han Confucianism and reestablish the rule of Dao, in both practice and theory, in government and learning. To avoid misunderstanding, most scholars today prefer to translate xuanxue as “Dark Learning,” or more clumsily but less ambiguous, “Learning of the Mysterious (Dao).”

Although the Wei dynasty had to contend with two rival kingdoms during its early years, there was a sense of optimism that order could be restored. There were eager attempts to reform public administration, especially the process of appointment of officials, and law. During the Zhengshi reign period (240–249) of the Wei dynasty in particular, there was a flurry of intellectual activities that saw the first wave of xuanxue scholars arriving on the scene. Zhong Hui was a significant player in this development.

Zhong Hui hailed from a distinguished family, politically influential and known especially for its expertise in law. His father, Zhong You (d. 230), was one of the most powerful statesmen in the early Wei regime and a noted calligrapher and Yijing expert as well. From the start, Zhong Hui was groomed to follow in his father’s footsteps. Zhong Hui himself recounts that he began his formal education under the guidance of his mother with the Xiaojing (Classic of Filial Piety) at the age of three. He then studied the Analects, Shijing (Classic of Poetry), Shujing (Book of Documents), the Yijing (with his father’s commentary), and other classics before he was sent to the imperial academy to further his studies at the age of fourteen. The Zhong family evidently held a special interest in the Yijing and the Laozi. Zhong You had written on both, and Zhong Hui’s mother was also a dedicated student of the Laozi and the Yijing.

As Zhong Hui’s biography in the Sanguozhi (History of the Three Kingdoms) relates, he began his official career as an assistant in the palace library during the Zhengshi era. Reputed for his wide learning and skill in disputation, he was soon promoted to serve as a deputy secretary at the Central Secretariat. At that time, Cao Shuang (d. 249) controlled the Wei court. On the intellectual front, many looked to He Yan (d. 249) as their leader. Zhong Hui was then part of this elite circle. He and Wang Bi (226–249), in particular, were singled out as among the brightest and most promising of their generation. (Wang Bi, of course, now occupies a hallowed place in the history of Chinese philosophy as a brilliant interpreter of the Laozi and the Yijing.)

The scene took a sudden change in 249 when Sima Yi (179–251) successfully staged a coup that led to the death of Cao Shuang, He Yan, and other members of their faction. After Sima Yi’s death, control of the Wei government came into the hands of his two sons, Sima Shi (208–255) and Sima Zhao (211–265). In 265, the latter’s son, Sima Yan, (236–290) formally ended the reign of Wei and established the Jin dynasty (265–420).

The fall of Cao Shuang and He Yan in 249 marked a turning point in Wei politics. Zhong Hui managed to keep out of harm’s way despite his apparent association with the Cao faction. After 249, Zhong Hui was able to retain his post at the Central Secretariat and soon became a key member of the Sima regime. Rising from Palace Attendant to Metropolitan Commandant, and to General of the Suppression of the West in 262, Zhong Hui achieved remarkable success in the political arena. In 263, in recognition of his role in the conquest of the rival kingdom of Shu, he was made Chief Minister of Culture and Instruction, one of the “Three Excellencies” of state. At the height of his power, Zhong Hui considered his achievement to be unsurpassed in the world and that he could no longer serve under anyone. Calculating that he had control of a formidable army and that he could at least claim the land of Shu even if he failed to conquer the entire country, Zhong Hui decided to turn against the Sima government. He was killed by his own troops in the first month of 264.

2. Zhong Hui’s Laozi Learning

Few of Zhong Hui’s writings have survived. A Zhong Hui ji (Collected Works) in nine scrolls has been reported, but it is no longer extant. He was also an accomplished poet; a few fragments of his poetry in the fu (prose-poem) style have been preserved in various sources. Zhong Hui seems to have written two essays on the Yijing, although little of his Yijing learning can now be reconstructed. He was the author of a commentary on the Laozi. He also contributed significantly to a debate on the relationship between “capacity and nature” (caixing).

In early medieval China, caixing was one of the basic topics about which every intellectual was expected to be able to say something. Fu Jia (also pronounced Fu Gu, 209–255), who criticized He Yan during the Zhengshi era and later acted as a major policy maker in the Sima administration, is generally acknowledged to be the leading figure in this debate. Zhong Hui, who became a junior associate of Fu Jia after 249, is said to have “collected and discussed” the latter’s deliberation on the “identity and difference of capacity and nature.” Zhong’s work presents four views on the subject, including his own, and is given the title Caixing siben lun (On the Four Roots of Capacity and Nature). Despite its evident popularity in Wei-Jin China, other than the general position of the four views and the individuals who hold them, which will be introduced later, we have no further knowledge of this work.

According to Du Guangting (850–933), He Yan, Wang Bi, and Zhong Hui all attempted in their interpretation of the Laozi to make clear “the way of ultimate emptiness and nonaction, and of governing the family and the country.” Unfortunately, Zhong Hui’s Laozi commentary has been lost, probably since the end of the Song dynasty (960-1279). Today, we can only see glimpses of Zhong’s Laozi learning through about 25 quotations from his commentary preserved in a number of sources.

When xuanxue became an established trend during the Jin dynasty, its supporters looked back to the Zhengshi period rather nostalgically as the “golden age” of philosophical debate and criticism. The concept of wu—variously translated as “nothing,” “nothingness,” “nonbeing” or “negativity”—is often singled out as the key to this new learning. As the Jin scholar Wang Yan (256–311) puts it, “During the Zhengshi period, He Yan, Wang Bi, and others propounded the teachings of Laozi and Zhuangzi. They established the view that heaven and earth and the myriad things are all rooted in wu.” Zhong Hui was among the “others” who sought to reformulate classical learning by focusing on the mysterious Dao, on the basis of which government and society may be restructured to establish lasting peace and order. What must be emphasized is that xuanxue is not monolithic. The concept of wu generates a new focus, but it is subject to interpretation, with different ethical and political implications.

a. The “Nothingness” of Dao

The concept of wu fundamentally serves to bring out the mystery of Dao, which is “nameless” and “formless,” according to the Laozi, and as such transcends language and sensory perception. As Zhong Hui understands it, the Dao is “shadowy, dark, dim, and obscure; it is therefore described as xuan” (commentary to Laozi 1). The Dao is also described as “silent and void” in the Laozi. This means, Zhong explains, that it is “empty and without substance” (comm. to Laozi 25).

Though formless and nameless, dark and mysterious, the Dao is nonetheless said to be the “beginning” and “mother” of all things (e.g., Laozi 1 and 42). Indeed, according to the Laozi, “All things under heaven are born of you (something); you is born of wu (nothing)” (ch. 40). This obviously requires explanation.

Life is essentially constituted by “vital energy” (qi). This can be regarded as the generally accepted view in traditional China. Applied to the Laozi, this suggests that the Dao should be understood as the source of the essential qi that generated the yin and yang energies at the “beginning.” Through a process of further differentiation, the created order then came into being. As the origin of the vital energy or cosmic “pneuma” that makes life possible, the Dao is indeed formless and nameless, and for this reason may be described as “nothing” (wu), in the sense of not having any characteristics of things. But, wu does not connote metaphysical “nonbeing,” “negativity,” or absence. Zhong Hui shares this view. In contrast, Wang Bi emphasizes in his commentary on the Laozi that the multiplicity of beings logically demands a prior ontological unity. From this perspective, “Dao” does not refer to a kind of primordial, undifferentiated substance, formless and of which nothing can be said; rather, it signifies the necessary ground of being.

According to the Laozi, “Heaven models after the Dao. The Dao models after what is naturally so (ziran)” (ch. 25). According to Zhong Hui, the reason the Dao is described as ziran is that “no one knows whence it comes.” Moreover, the Laozi observes, “The great image does not have any form” (ch. 41). The context suggests that the “great image” is a metaphor for the Dao, and this is how Zhong Hui has understood it: “There is no image that does not respond to it; this is what is called the ‘great image’. Since it does not have any bodily shape, how can it have any form or appearance?” In these instances, the mystery of Dao has little to do with “nonbeing” as an abstract concept, but rather intimates the ever-existing and formless nature of the generative force that brought forth heaven and earth and the myriad beings.

The Dao is also called the “One,” as Zhong Hui interprets the Laozi. It is “ceaseless, indeed, yet it does not have any ties; overflowing, yet it does not become diminished. Subtle and wondrous, it is difficult to name it. In the end, it returns to a state of not being anything (with discernible characteristics)” (comm. to Laozi 14; cf. comm. to Laozi 39). Limitless and ultimately unfathomable, the Dao is indeed “subtle and wondrous” and therefore “difficult to name,” but it is a real presence. The Laozi states that the Dao “stands on its own and does not change.” Zhong Hui explains, “Solitary, without a mate, it is therefore said to be ‘standing on its own’. From antiquity to the present, it is always one and the same; thus it is stated, it ‘does not change’” (comm. to Laozi 25). Further, the Laozi specifically points out that the Dao “operates everywhere and is free from danger” (ch. 25). Zhong Hui’s commentary here reads: “There is no place that the Dao is not present; it is (thus) described as ‘operating everywhere’. Where it is present, it penetrates everything; thus it is without danger.”

For Zhong Hui, the concept of Dao thus explains from a cosmological perspective the genesis of being and the emergence of order in the cosmos. The Laozi may seem to privilege the concept of wu, to bring out the indefinable fullness of the Dao, over the concept of you, which subsumes under it the world of things, but in the final analysis the two are interdependent in enabling the proper functioning of the universe. Finding an apt illustration in a common mode of transportation in early China, the Laozi thus announces in chapter 11 that “thirty spokes” join into one hub; but the use or function of the wheel, and by extension the carriage or cart as a whole, is not so much dependent on the solid spokes as the empty space within the hub. Similarly, clay may be shaped and treated to make vessels, and doors and windows cut out to make a room; but it is the “emptiness” of the vessel or room that makes possible its use or function. “Therefore,” the Laozi concludes, “having something (you) is what produces benefit, (but) having nothing (wu) is what produces use.”

To Zhong Hui, the Laozi makes use of these metaphors “to bring to light that you and wu gain from each other, and neither can be neglected …. Wu depends on you to become of benefit; you relies on wu to be of use.” The relationship between wu and you may be likened to that between “interiority” (nei) and “externality” (wai)—concrete objects are able to function and generate value externally because of their inner capacity endowed by the Dao in the form of vital energies. The interdependence of you and wu represents an intrinsic “law” in a Dao-centered universe (comm. to Laozi 11). This has important ethical implications.

b. Self-Cultivation, Great Peace, and the Nature of the Sage

Derived from the Dao, the world reflects a pristine order. In the ideal Dao-centered world, filial love and respect, for example, would be entirely spontaneous and thus unremarkable, which is why the Laozi regards “filial piety” in the Confucian sense as a virtue that merits praise and has to be perfected if not acquired as having arisen only after the decline of the Dao (Laozi 18). Deliberate effort at bringing love and respect into the world, in other words, proves necessary only after natural filial affection has been lost. Thus Zhong Hui writes, “If the nine generations of the family are all in accord, then love and respect will have no cause to be applied. ‘When the six relations are not in harmony’ [as the Laozi phrases it], then filial piety and compassion will become conspicuous.” The concept of “naturalness” (ziran), in this sense, involves not only the regularity of natural processes and the plenitude of nature but also a perceived “natural” harmony and order in the social arena.

The pristine Dao-derived order has been lost. The aim of xuanxue is to restore this order. For Zhong Hui, the process of recovery begins with self-cultivation, which requires careful tending of one’s qi-energy. According to Zhong Hui, “the soul manages and protects its form and qi, so as to enable it to last long.” This is why the Laozi urges the people to “look after the soul and embrace the One” (comm. to Laozi 10).

Aligned with the yin-yang, cosmological theory, the idea that human beings are constituted spiritually and physically by qi was well established by the third century. No bifurcation of “soul” and “body” is implied. Both are constituted by qi, although the “qi of the blood” may be less “pure” when compared with the more subtle qi of the soul or spirit. In this context, self-cultivation involves both nourishing and purifying the vital qi-energy.

Chapter 12 of the Laozi warns that the “five colors cause one’s eyes to become blind,” and of the other harmful effects that stem from indulging in one’s senses. The Laozi concludes: “For this reason the sage is for the belly and not for the eyes.” Emphasizing the importance of self-cultivation, Zhong Hui relates this to the being of the ideal sage: “The genuine vital energy pervades (the sage’s) inner being; thus it is said, (he is) ‘for the belly’. Externally, desires have been eliminated; thus, it is said, ‘not for the eyes’.”

Here, the complementarity of the “inner” and the “outer” again guides Zhong Hui’s interpretation. The sage is always mindful of his qi-nature in everything he does and certainly does not live to satisfy the senses. On the opening sentence of Laozi 16—“Attain utmost emptiness; maintain complete tranquility”—Zhong Hui again stresses this point: “… eliminate emotions and worries to reach the ultimate of emptiness. The mind is always quiet, so as to maintain complete tranquility.”

Self-cultivation translates into certain effects or ways of doing things at both the personal and political levels. The Laozi states: “The yielding and weak will overcome the hard and strong” (ch. 36). In this same chapter, the Laozi elaborates, “If you would have a thing shrink, stretch it first.” Zhong Hui comments: “If one wishes to control the hard and strong, one assumes the appearance of being submissive and weak. Stretch it first; shrink it afterward—win or lose, (the outcome) is certain.” In chapter 22, the Laozi brings out the central Daoist insight that preservation or fulfillment does not lie in self-aggrandizement or aggressive action but in self-effacement and non-contention, in embracing humility and the way of “yieldingness.” “If one is truly able to keep being yielding,” Zhong Hui reasons, then “everything will certainly return to him”—that is to say, all successes and benefits will as a matter of course belong to him. In the ideal Dao-centered world, this would describe the being of the sage-ruler, who abides by naturalness, acts with “nonaction” (wuwei) in the sense of yieldingness, and whose inner tranquility would ensure the absence of selfish desire and the flourishing of the realm.

The sage is someone who possesses “superior virtue,” as the Laozi describes it. Zhong Hui explains: “(He who) embodies the wondrous and subtle spirit to preserve the transformations (of nature) is (the man of) superior virtue” (comm. to Laozi 38). In the government of the sage, penal laws and punishment do not apply, for the sage is able to transform the people through nonaction, guiding them to regain their natural simplicity (comm. to Laozi 19). This is the reign of “great peace” (taiping) as envisaged by the majority of xuanxue scholars, in which virtues would naturally abound and family relations would be in complete harmony. Can great peace be attained? There is no question that a sage can realize the taiping ideal; but is it the case that sages alone can bring about great peace? Can it not be realized by worthy and able rulers and ministers, who are committed to the way of the sage but are not sages? Zhong Hui could not but be concerned with this question, which began to surface during the Han period and continued to attract debate during the early years of the Wei dynasty. In fact, Zhong Hui’s father, Zhong You, asserts unequivocally that sages are necessary for the realization of great peace.

The role of the sage in realizing great peace presupposes a prior understanding of the nature of the sage. Is “sagehood” inborn, or can it be acquired through effort? This was a major topic of discussion also among the Wei elite. The prevalent view in early xuanxue seems to be that sages are born, not made, a view to which Zhong Hui subscribes and which stems directly from a cosmological understanding of the Dao, particularly the deciding role of qi in shaping the nature and destiny of human beings.

In a cosmological interpretation, the Dao informs all beings, provides them with a “share” of its potent energy, which accounts for their lifespan, capacity, and all other aspects of their being. Sages are exceptional beings, whose qi-endowment is extraordinarily pure and abundant. On this basis, He Yan, for example, thus argues that “sages do not have emotions,” which attracted a substantial following during the Zhengshi period. Zhong Hui was drawn to He Yan’s view and is said to have developed it in his own thinking. As the Sanguozhi relates, “He Yan maintained that the sage does not have pleasure and anger, or sorrow and joy. His views were extremely cogent, on which Zhong Hui and others elaborated.”

Emotions are “impure” qi-agitations that disturb the mind and render impossible the work of sagely government. The sage, blessed with the finest and richest energy that arises from the “One,” is free from such qi-imperfections, which enables him to be absolutely impartial and to realize great peace not only within himself but also in government. The sage, in other words, is utterly different from ordinary human beings. On this view, this is a basic difference in qi-constitution, which amounts to a difference in kind and not in degree. “Sagehood,” in other words, should be understood in terms of a sage nature that is inborn and not an accomplished goal that is attainable through learning and effort.

If Zhong Hui is of the view that sage nature is inborn, why does he emphasize self-cultivation to fortify the qi within and to eliminate desires? As we have seen also, Zhong Hui affirms that the “soul,” if properly managed and protected, can “last long.” Does this show that he believes in the existence of “immortals” (xian) and that it is possible to attain immortality? In a fu poem on the chrysanthemum (Juhuafu), Zhong Hui writes, “Thus, the chrysanthemum … [if ingested] flows within and renders the body light; it is the food of immortals.” Further, in the same poem, Zhong rhapsodizes, “Those who ingest it would live long, and those who consume it would find their spirit unobstructed.” Zhong Hui has also written a fu on grapes (Putaofu), in which he describes the fruit as “having embodied the finest qi in nature.”

It is not surprising that Zhong Hui accepts the existence of immortals, which was a widely held belief at that time. Whether it is an immortal or a sage, the same reasoning applies. Only a select few are endowed at birth with the necessary qi-condition to develop into a sage or immortal. An ordinary human being cannot learn to become a sage, who is a different kind of being, but self-cultivation remains important because it is possible to nourish and purify one’s qi-endowment by means of certain substances and practices. In other words, although complete “transcendence” may be beyond reach, one can remove obstacles to personal fulfillment, prevent corruption of one’s nature, and ensure that one’s capacity is developed to the fullest.

The idea that only sages can realize great peace is grounded in this conception of the nature of the sage. If one believes, as Zhong Hui does, that the sage is of a special breed, absolutely pure and without cognitive-affective qi-disturbances, it would not make much sense to say that even those who are not sages could realize the reign of great peace. The uniqueness of the sage would then be inconsequential. Zhong Hui would thus agree with his father that great peace is an ideal realizable only by sages. Opposed to this is the view that it is possible to attain great peace even without the intervention of sages. What is crucial is that we learn from the ancient sages. If able and worthy individuals such as Yi Yin of the Shang dynasty and Yan Yuan (Yan Hui), the exemplary disciple of Confucius, were entrusted with governing the country, and if their policies would continue for several generations, then great peace may be realized.

From this latter perspective, the difference between a sage such as Confucius and worthies such as Yan Yuan is a matter of degree. Moreover, this implies that we can learn from the sages and worthies, which signals a particular Confucian approach to government and education. Benevolent government requires men of integrity and talent to serve the public good. Education is necessary to transmit the teaching of the sages and to lay a strong moral foundation. Care and compassion are required in the administration of justice. Step by step, with rulers and ministers serving as examples, the transformative power of Confucian virtues would instill benevolence and propriety in the hearts of the people or at least render them willing and obedient subjects. In this way, lasting order and peace may be secured.

Both camps considered Confucius to be the ideal sage. But whereas to some, Confucius was a great teacher, to others he embodied the best of heaven and earth. It would be impossible to be like Confucius in every respect, according to the latter; the assertion that great peace could be realized by able and worthy men would undermine the supra-mundane status of Confucius, who was such an exalted figure as to exclude the possibility of someone else matching his attainment. The sage is fundamentally different from “mere” mortals, and the sage alone can realize lasting peace. This implies a certain distrust of the nature and capacity of the people, who are driven by desires. It is important thus to curb one’s desires and to maintain tranquility. But this, too, can only be achieved by a few. For the majority, laws and models are necessary. They serve as the “outer” instruments that would complement the call to embrace “emptiness” within.

The concept of “law” (fa) is not limited to criminal justice. It concerns proper rulership and sociopolitical order at large. The principles of government must be clearly delineated for the rule of law to apply. In particular, the various duties and functions of officials must be carefully defined, so that there is accountability and quality control. Precisely because great peace can be realized only by sages, and given that sages are rare, government should depend on laws and processes, as opposed to individuals, so that official positions and duties would be occupied and performed by the right persons, laws and punishment would be appropriate, and in all aspects the “inner” and the “outer” would attain their proper balance.

3. The Debate on Capacity and Nature

Although the evidence at our disposal is limited, a consistent approach emerges from the surviving fragments of Zhong Hui’s Laozi commentary. Guided by a hermeneutic that equates the nothingness of Dao with the fullness of qi, Zhong Hui probes the basis of personal well-being and sociopolitical order. The pristine order of the Dao is characterized by intrinsic laws and standards, which ensure the smooth functioning of the cosmos and the integrity of sociopolitical institutions. Order would flourish in this ideal world, and remedial action would be superfluous. In a world where the Dao has declined, only a true sage can realize genuine order and peace. In the absence of a sage-ruler, due process is required to ensure sound governance, social stability and that justice prevails. In the context of early Wei politics, the system of official appointment would be of particular concern to those who seek to reestablish the rule of Dao.

In this context, the debate on capacity and nature may be understood. Zhong Hui is particularly noted for his contribution to this debate, which involves four positions—namely, that capacity and nature are the same (tong); that they are different (yi); that they coincide (he); and that they diverge from each other (li).

Fu Jia apparently initiated the debate by arguing for the first position. The second is represented by Li Feng (d. 254), who was Director of the Central Secretariat and whom Fu Jia denounced as pretentious and false. Zhong Hui held the third view, and Wang Guang (d. 251), who like Zhong Hui was a junior officer during the Zhengshi period, argued for the last position. Zhong Hui’s treatise, however, was no longer available by the early sixth century.

It has been suggested that the debate should be understood in terms of the political struggles between the Cao faction and the Sima faction during the Zhengshi period. Whereas Fu Jia and Zhong Hui (before his attempted revolt) sided with the Sima regime, both Li Feng and Wang Guang were struck down by it. This is an important observation. However, philosophically, what does it mean to say that capacity and nature are the same? In what sense can they be said to “coincide”?

The first position seems relatively straightforward in the light of the concept of qi. Inborn nature can be understood in terms of one’s innate capacity, which encompasses one’s physical, intellectual, moral, psychological, and spiritual endowments. In Fu Jia’s account, both capacity and nature are seen to be determined by qi-endowment. Whereas nature is the inner substance, capacity reaches outward and translates into ability as well as moral conduct. This view finds eloquent support in the Caixing lun (Treatise on Capacity and Nature) by another third-century scholar, Yuan Zhun. All beings that exist in heaven and earth, according to Yuan, can be either excellent or of a bad quality. Whereas the former is endowed with a “pure qi,” the latter is constituted by a “turbid energy.” It is like a piece of wood, Yuan adds: whether it is crooked or straight is a matter of nature, on the basis of which it has a certain capacity that can be made to serve particular ends. The same is true for human beings, who may be “worthy” or “unworthy” by nature. To argue that nature and capacity are the same, Fu Jia cannot but maintain also that sagacity is inborn.

Li Feng counters that capacity and nature are different. Fu Jia had misconstrued the relationship between capacity and nature, because whereas nature may be inborn, capacity is shaped by learning. This suggests that any accomplishment, moral or political, is ultimately dependent on effort. Fu Jia is evidently committed to affirming that a person may be born good or bad, strong or weak, bright or dull, depending on his or her qi-endowment. Li Feng’s counterview, however, proceeds on the premise that nature is “neutral” or unmarked, morally and in all other respects. What is endowed at birth is simply the biological apparatus to grow and to learn, but the person one becomes is a matter of learning and putting into practice the teachings of the sages. Yu Huan, a third-century historian, provides a helpful analogy: the effect of learning on a person is like adding color to a piece of plain silk. This should align with the view that sagehood can be achieved through effort and that sages are not necessary to realizing great peace, given the perceived transformative power of learning.

Zhong Hui’s position may be seen as an attempt to mediate between these two opposing views. Given Zhong Hui’s understanding of qi and the nature of the sage, he would obviously side with Fu Jia in this debate. Yet, the “identity” thesis seems to assume that what is endowed is both necessary and sufficient. Although native endowment is necessary for realized capacity, Zhong Hui is saying, it is not sufficient. Thus, when capacity is said to “coincide” with nature, Zhong Hui is in effect proposing that what is endowed is potential, which must be carefully nurtured and brought to completion. For immortals and sages, who are different in kind because of their exceptional qi-endowment, what is inner in the sense of innate capacity naturally manifests itself completely in extraordinary achievements. For ordinary human beings, however, nature does not amount to actual ability but only furnishes certain dispositions or directions of development. To be sure, if the native endowment is extremely poor, there is not much that can be done. Nevertheless, the real challenge to the identity thesis is that an excellent endowment may go to waste because the person succumbs to desire and would not learn. The inner provides the capital, but it requires external control to maintain its value, to generate profit, and to bring the investment to a successful close.

In response to Li Feng’s critique of Fu Jia, Zhong Hui thus offers a modified identity thesis that takes into account the place of learning and effort. Although having the “right stuff,” as it were, is not sufficient, one must have some material to begin with in order to achieve the desired result. Thus, it cannot be said that the latter has nothing to do with the former. In this context, Wang Guang adds a fourth view, which is stronger than Li Feng’s and appears to be directed especially against Zhong Hui’s position. Inborn nature does not provide the necessary fertile ground for cultivation; rather, it needs to be rectified by learning. Human beings are naturally driven by desire and therefore must rely on rituals and instruction to become responsible individuals. In this sense, capacity and nature do not “coincide” but “diverge” from each other.

The debate on caixing demonstrates the richness and complexity of xuanxue. The debate may have particular political relevance, but it presupposes an understanding of the origin and structure of the cosmos, the role of self-cultivation, the rule of law, the nature of the sage, and other issues central to Wei-Jin thought. The four views engage one another in coming to terms with the basis of goodness and other forms of excellence. Zhong Hui’s view on capacity and nature is consistent with his interpretation of the Laozi, both of which should be recognized as a major contribution to xuanxue philosophy. Had he not attempted to topple the Sima regime, or more precisely had he not failed in that attempt, no doubt his writings would have been preserved and given the attention they justly deserve.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Berkowitz, Alan J. Patterns of Disengagement: the Practice and Portrayal of Reclusion in Early Medieval China. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000.
  • Cai, Zong-qi, ed. Chinese Aesthetics: The Ordering of Literature, the Arts, and the Universe in the Six Dynasties. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 2004.
  • Chan, Alan K. L. Two Visions of the Way. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1991.
  • Chan, Alan K. L. “The Essential Meaning of the Way and Virtue: Yan Zun and ‘Laozi Learning’ in Early Han China.” Monumenta Serica 46 (1998): 105–127.
  • Chan, Alan K. L. “The Daodejing and Its Tradition.” In Daoism Handbook, ed. Livia Kohn (Leiden: E.J. Brill, 2000), 1–29.
  • Chan, Alan K. L. “Zhong Hui’s Laozi Commentary and the Debate on Capacity and Nature in Third-Century China.” Early China 28 (2003): 101–159.
  • Chan, Alan K. L. “What are the ‘Four Roots of Capacity and Nature?” In Wisdom in China and the West, eds. Vincent Shen and Willard Oxtoby (Washington: Council for Research in Values and Philosophy, 2004), 143–184.
  • Chan, Wing-tsit, trans. The Way of Lao Tzu. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1963.
  • Henricks, Robert. Philosophy and Argumentation in Third Century China: The Essays by Hsi K’ang. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1983.
  • Holzman, Donald. Poetry and Politics: The Life and Works of Juan Chi (210-263). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1976.
  • Holzman, Donald. La vie et la pensée de Hi Kang (223-262 AP. J.-C.). Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1957.
  • Knechtges, David R., trans. Wen xuan, or Selections of Refined Literature. 3 vols. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1982–1996.
  • Kohn, Livia. Early Chinese Mysticism: Philosophy and Soteriology in the Taoist Tradition. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1992.
  • Lynn, Richard J., trans. The Classic of Changes: A New Translation of the I Ching as Interpreted by Wang Bi. New York: Columbia University Press, 1994.
  • Lynn, Richard J., trans. The Classic of the Way and Virtue: A New Translation of the Tao-te ching of Laozi as Interpreted by Wang Bi. New York: Columbia University Press, 1999.
  • Mather, Richard B. “The Controversy over Conformity and Naturalness during the Six Dynasties.” History of Religions 9 (1969–70): 160–180.
  • Mather, Richard B., trans. Shih-shuo Hsin-yü: A New Account of Tales of the World, by Liu I-ch’ing. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1976.
  • Robinet, Isabelle. Les commentaires du Tao to king jusqu’au VIIe siècle. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1977.
  • Shih, Vincent Y. C., trans. The Literary Mind and the Carving of Dragons. Hong Kong: Chinese University Press, 1983.
  • Shryock, J. K., trans. The Study of Human Abilities: The Jen Wu Chih of Liu Shao. American Oriental Series, vol. 11. New Haven: American Oriental Society, 1937; reprint, New York, 1966.
  • Tang, Yongtong. “Wang Bi’s New Interpretation of the I Ching and the Lun-yü.” Trans.Walter Liebenthal. Harvard Journal of Asiatic Studies 10 (1947): 124–161.
  • Wagner, Rudolf G. The Craft of a Chinese Commentator: Wang Bi on the Laozi. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2000.
  • Wagner, Rudolf G. Language, Ontology, and Political Philosophy in China: Wang Bi’s Scholarly Exploration of the Dark (Xuanxue). Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.
  • Wagner, Rudolf G., trans. A Chinese Reading of the Daodejing: Wang Bi’s Commentary on the Laozi with Critical Text and Translation. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.
  • Yates, Robin D. S., trans. Five Lost Classics: Tao, Huanglao, and Yin-Yang in Han China. New York: Ballantine Books, 1997.
  • Yü, Ying-shih. “Individualism and the Neo-Taoist Movement in Wei-Chin China.” In Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald J. Munro (Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985), 121–155.
  • Ziporyn, Brook. The Penumbra Unbound: the Neo-Taoist Philosophy of Guo Xiang. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.

Author Information

Alan Kam-Leung Chan
Email: alanchan@nus.edu.sg
National University of Singapore
Singapore

Epistemology

Epistemology is the study of knowledge. Epistemologists concern themselves with a number of tasks, which we might sort into two categories.

First, we must determine the nature of knowledge; that is, what does it mean to say that someone knows, or fails to know, something? This is a matter of understanding what knowledge is, and how to distinguish between cases in which someone knows something and cases in which someone does not know something. While there is some general agreement about some aspects of this issue, we shall see that this question is much more difficult than one might imagine.

Second, we must determine the extent of human knowledge; that is, how much do we, or can we, know? How can we use our reason, our senses, the testimony of others, and other resources to acquire knowledge? Are there limits to what we can know? For instance, are some things unknowable? Is it possible that we do not know nearly as much as we think we do? Should we have a legitimate worry about skepticism, the view that we do not or cannot know anything at all?

Although this article provides an overview of the important issues, it leaves the most basic questions unanswered; epistemology will continue to be an area of philosophical discussion as long as these questions remain.

Table of Contents

  1. Kinds of Knowledge
  2. The Nature of Propositional Knowledge
    1. Belief
    2. Truth
    3. Justification
    4. The Gettier Problem
      1. The No-False-Belief Condition
      2. The No-Defeaters Condition
      3. Causal Accounts of Knowledge
  3. The Nature of Justification
    1. Internalism
      1. Foundationalism
      2. Coherentism
    2. Externalism
  4. The Extent of Human Knowledge
    1. Sources of Knowledge
    2. Skepticism
    3. Cartesian Skepticism
    4. Humean Skepticism
      1. Numerical vs. Qualitative Identity
      2. Hume’s Skepticism about Induction
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Kinds of Knowledge

The term “epistemology” comes from the Greek “episteme,” meaning “knowledge,” and “logos,” meaning, roughly, “study, or science, of.” “Logos” is the root of all terms ending in “-ology” – such as psychology, anthropology – and of “logic,” and has many other related meanings.

The word “knowledge” and its cognates are used in a variety of ways. One common use of the word “know” is as an expression of psychological conviction. For instance, we might hear someone say, “I just knew it wouldn’t rain, but then it did.” While this may be an appropriate usage, philosophers tend to use the word “know” in a factive sense, so that one cannot know something that is not the case. (This point is discussed at greater length in section 2b below.)

Even if we restrict ourselves to factive usages, there are still multiple senses of “knowledge,” and so we need to distinguish between them. One kind of knowledge is procedural knowledge, sometimes called competence or “know-how;” for example, one can know how to ride a bicycle, or one can know how to drive from Washington, D.C. to New York. Another kind of knowledge is acquaintance knowledge or familiarity; for instance, one can know the department chairperson, or one can know Philadelphia.

Epistemologists typically do not focus on procedural or acquaintance knowledge, however, instead preferring to focus on propositional knowledge. A proposition is something which can be expressed by a declarative sentence, and which purports to describe a fact or a state of affairs, such as “Dogs are mammals,” “2+2=7,” “It is wrong to murder innocent people for fun.” (Note that a proposition may be true or false; that is, it need not actually express a fact.) Propositional knowledge, then, can be called knowledge-that; statements of propositional knowledge (or the lack thereof) are properly expressed using “that”-clauses, such as “He knows that Houston is in Texas,” or “She does not know that the square root of 81 is 9.” In what follows, we will be concerned only with propositional knowledge.

Propositional knowledge, obviously, encompasses knowledge about a wide range of matters: scientific knowledge, geographical knowledge, mathematical knowledge, self-knowledge, and knowledge about any field of study whatever. Any truth might, in principle, be knowable, although there might be unknowable truths. One goal of epistemology is to determine the criteria for knowledge so that we can know what can or cannot be known, in other words, the study of epistemology fundamentally includes the study of meta-epistemology (what we can know about knowledge itself).

We can also distinguish between different types of propositional knowledge, based on the source of that knowledge. Non-empirical or a priori knowledge is possible independently of, or prior to, any experience, and requires only the use of reason; examples include knowledge of logical truths such as the law of non-contradiction, as well as knowledge of abstract claims (such as ethical claims or claims about various conceptual matters). Empirical or a posteriori knowledge is possible only subsequent, or posterior, to certain sense experiences (in addition to the use of reason); examples include knowledge of the color or shape of a physical object or knowledge of geographical locations. (Some philosophers, called rationalists, believe that all knowledge is ultimately grounded upon reason; others, called empiricists, believe that all knowledge is ultimately grounded upon experience.) A thorough epistemology should, of course, address all kinds of knowledge, although there might be different standards for a priori and a posteriori knowledge.

We can also distinguish between individual knowledge and collective knowledge. Social epistemology is the subfield of epistemology that addresses the way that groups, institutions, or other collective bodies might come to acquire knowledge.

2. The Nature of Propositional Knowledge

Having narrowed our focus to propositional knowledge, we must ask ourselves what, exactly, constitutes knowledge. What does it mean for someone to know something? What is the difference between someone who knows something and someone else who does not know it, or between something one knows and something one does not know? Since the scope of knowledge is so broad, we need a general characterization of knowledge, one which is applicable to any kind of proposition whatsoever. Epistemologists have usually undertaken this task by seeking a correct and complete analysis of the concept of knowledge, in other words a set of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions which determine whether someone knows something.

a. Belief

Let us begin with the observation that knowledge is a mental state; that is, knowledge exists in one’s mind, and unthinking things cannot know anything. Further, knowledge is a specific kind of mental state. While “that”-clauses can also be used to describe desires and intentions, these cannot constitute knowledge. Rather, knowledge is a kind of belief. If one has no beliefs about a particular matter, one cannot have knowledge about it.

For instance, suppose that I desire that I be given a raise in salary, and that I intend to do whatever I can to earn one. Suppose further that I am doubtful as to whether I will indeed be given a raise, due to the intricacies of the university’s budget and such. Given that I do not believe that I will be given a raise, I cannot be said to know that I will. Only if I am inclined to believe something can I come to know it. Similarly, thoughts that an individual has never entertained are not among his beliefs, and thus cannot be included in his body of knowledge.

Some beliefs, those which the individual is actively entertaining, are called occurrent beliefs. The majority of an individual’s beliefs are non-occurrent; these are beliefs that the individual has in the background but is not entertaining at a particular time. Correspondingly, most of our knowledge is non-occurrent, or background, knowledge; only a small amount of one’s knowledge is ever actively on one’s mind.

b. Truth

Knowledge, then, requires belief. Of course, not all beliefs constitute knowledge. Belief is necessary but not sufficient for knowledge. We are all sometimes mistaken in what we believe; in other words, while some of our beliefs are true, others are false. As we try to acquire knowledge, then, we are trying to increase our stock of true beliefs (while simultaneously minimizing our false beliefs).

We might say that the most typical purpose of beliefs is to describe or capture the way things actually are; that is, when one forms a belief, one is seeking a match between one’s mind and the world. (We sometimes, of course, form beliefs for other reasons – to create a positive attitude, to deceive ourselves, and so forth – but when we seek knowledge, we are trying to get things right.) And, alas, we sometimes fail to achieve such a match; some of our beliefs do not describe the way things actually are.

Note that we are assuming here that there is such a thing as objective truth, so that it is possible for beliefs to match or to fail to match with reality. That is, in order for someone to know something, there must be something one knows about. Recall that we are discussing knowledge in the factive sense; if there are no facts of the matter, then there’s nothing to know (or to fail to know). This assumption is not universally accepted – in particular, it is not shared by some proponents of relativism – but it will not be defended here. However, we can say that truth is a condition of knowledge; that is, if a belief is not true, it cannot constitute knowledge. Accordingly, if there is no such thing as truth, then there can be no knowledge. Even if there is such a thing as truth, if there is a domain in which there are no truths, then there can be no knowledge within that domain. (For example, if beauty is in the eye of the beholder, then a belief that something is beautiful cannot be true or false, and thus cannot constitute knowledge.)

c. Justification

Knowledge, then, requires factual belief. However, this does not suffice to capture the nature of knowledge. Just as knowledge requires successfully achieving the objective of true belief, it also requires success with regard to the formation of that belief. In other words, not all true beliefs constitute knowledge; only true beliefs arrived at in the right way constitute knowledge.

What, then, is the right way of arriving at beliefs? In addition to truth, what other properties must a belief have in order to constitute knowledge? We might begin by noting that sound reasoning and solid evidence seem to be the way to acquire knowledge. By contrast, a lucky guess cannot constitute knowledge. Similarly, misinformation and faulty reasoning do not seem like a recipe for knowledge, even if they happen to lead to a true belief. A belief is said to be justified if it is obtained in the right way. While justification seems, at first glance, to be a matter of a belief’s being based on evidence and reasoning rather than on luck or misinformation, we shall see that there is much disagreement regarding how to spell out the details.

The requirement that knowledge involve justification does not necessarily mean that knowledge requires absolute certainty, however. Humans are fallible beings, and fallibilism is the view that it is possible to have knowledge even when one’s true belief might have turned out to be false. Between beliefs which were necessarily true and those which are true solely by luck lies a spectrum of beliefs with regard to which we had some defeasible reason to believe that they would be true. For instance, if I heard the weatherman say that there is a 90% chance of rain, and as a result I formed the belief that it would rain, then my true belief that it would rain was not true purely by luck. Even though there was some chance that my belief might have been false, there was a sufficient basis for that belief for it to constitute knowledge. This basis is referred to as the justification for that belief. We can then say that, to constitute knowledge, a belief must be both true and justified.

Note that because of luck, a belief can be unjustified yet true; and because of human fallibility, a belief can be justified yet false. In other words, truth and justification are two independent conditions of beliefs. The fact that a belief is true does not tell us whether or not it is justified; that depends on how the belief was arrived at. So, two people might hold the same true belief, but for different reasons, so that one of them is justified and the other is unjustified. Similarly, the fact that a belief is justified does not tell us whether it’s true or false. Of course, a justified belief will presumably be more likely to be true than to be false, and justified beliefs will presumably be more likely or more probable to be true than unjustified beliefs. (As we will see in section 3 below, the exact nature of the relationship between truth and justification is contentious.)

d. The Gettier Problem

For some time, the justified true belief (JTB) account was widely agreed to capture the nature of knowledge. However, in 1963, Edmund Gettier published a short but widely influential article which has shaped much subsequent work in epistemology. Gettier provided two examples in which someone had a true and justified belief, but in which we seem to want to deny that the individual has knowledge, because luck still seems to play a role in his belief having turned out to be true.

Consider an example. Suppose that the clock on campus (which keeps accurate time and is well maintained) stopped working at 11:56pm last night, and has yet to be repaired. On my way to my noon class, exactly twelve hours later, I glance at the clock and form the belief that the time is 11:56. My belief is true, of course, since the time is indeed 11:56. And my belief is justified, as I have no reason to doubt that the clock is working, and I cannot be blamed for basing beliefs about the time on what the clock says. Nonetheless, it seems evident that I do not know that the time is 11:56. After all, if I had walked past the clock a bit earlier or a bit later, I would have ended up with a false belief rather than a true one.

This example and others like it, while perhaps somewhat far-fetched, seem to show that it is possible for justified true belief to fail to constitute knowledge. To put it another way, the justification condition was meant to ensure that knowledge was based on solid evidence rather than on luck or misinformation, but Gettier-type examples seem to show that justified true belief can still involve luck and thus fall short of knowledge. This problem is referred to as “the Gettier problem.” To solve this problem, we must either show that all instances of justified true belief do indeed constitute knowledge, or alternatively refine our analysis of knowledge.

i. The No-False-Belief Condition

We might think that there is a simple and straightforward solution to the Gettier problem. Note that my reasoning was tacitly based on my belief that the clock is working properly, and that this belief is false. This seems to explain what has gone wrong in this example. Accordingly, we might revise our analysis of knowledge by insisting that to constitute knowledge, a belief must be true and justified and must be formed without relying on any false beliefs. In other words, we might say, justification, truth, and belief are all necessary for knowledge, but they are not jointly sufficient for knowledge; there is a fourth condition – namely, that no false beliefs be essentially involved in the reasoning that led to the belief – which is also necessary.

Unfortunately, this will not suffice; we can modify the example so that my belief is justified and true, and is not based on any false beliefs, but still falls short of knowledge. Suppose, for instance, that I do not have any beliefs about the clock’s current state, but merely the more general belief that the clock usually is in working order. This belief, which is true, would suffice to justify my belief that the time is now 11:56; of course, it still seems evident that I do not know the time.

ii. The No-Defeaters Condition

However, the no-false-belief condition does not seem to be completely misguided; perhaps we can add some other condition to justification and truth to yield a correct characterization of knowledge. Note that, even if I didn’t actively form the belief that the clock is currently working properly, it seems to be implicit in my reasoning, and the fact that it is false is surely relevant to the problem. After all, if I were asked, at the time that I looked at the clock, whether it is working properly, I would have said that it is. Conversely, if I believed that the clock wasn’t working properly, I wouldn’t be justified in forming a belief about the time based on what the clock says.

In other words, the proposition that the clock is working properly right now meets the following conditions: it is a false proposition, I do not realize that it is a false proposition, and if I had realized that it is a false proposition, my justification for my belief that it is 11:56 would have been undercut or defeated. If we call propositions such as this “defeaters,” then we can say that to constitute knowledge, a belief must be true and justified, and there must not be any defeaters to the justification of that belief. Many epistemologists believe this analysis to be correct.

iii. Causal Accounts of Knowledge

Rather than modifying the JTB account of knowledge by adding a fourth condition, some epistemologists see the Gettier problem as reason to seek a substantially different alternative. We have noted that knowledge should not involve luck, and that Gettier-type examples are those in which luck plays some role in the formation of a justified true belief. In typical instances of knowledge, the factors responsible for the justification of a belief are also responsible for its truth. For example, when the clock is working properly, my belief is both true and justified because it’s based on the clock, which accurately displays the time. But one feature that all Gettier-type examples have in common is the lack of a clear connection between the truth and the justification of the belief in question. For example, my belief that the time is 11:56 is justified because it’s based on the clock, but it’s true because I happened to walk by at just the right moment. So, we might insist that to constitute knowledge, a belief must be both true and justified, and its truth and justification must be connected somehow.

This notion of a connection between the truth and the justification of a belief turns out to be difficult to formulate precisely, but causal accounts of knowledge seek to capture the spirit of this proposal by more significantly altering the analysis of knowledge. Such accounts maintain that in order for someone to know a proposition, there must be a causal connection between his belief in that proposition and the fact that the proposition encapsulates. This retains the truth condition, since a proposition must be true in order for it to encapsulate a fact. However, it appears to be incompatible with fallibilism, since it does not allow for the possibility that a belief be justified yet false. (Strictly speaking, causal accounts of knowledge make no reference to justification, although we might attempt to reformulate fallibilism in somewhat modified terms in order to state this observation.)

While causal accounts of knowledge are no longer thought to be correct, they have engendered reliabilist theories of knowledge, which shall be discussed in section 3b below.

3. The Nature of Justification

One reason that the Gettier problem is so problematic is that neither Gettier nor anyone who preceded him has offered a sufficiently clear and accurate analysis of justification. We have said that justification is a matter of a belief’s having been formed in the right way, but we have yet to say what that amounts to. We must now consider this matter more closely.

We have noted that the goal of our belief-forming practices is to obtain truth while avoiding error, and that justification is the feature of beliefs which are formed in such a way as to best pursue this goal. If we think, then, of the goal of our belief-forming practices as an attempt to establish a match between one’s mind and the world, and if we also think of the application or withholding of the justification condition as an evaluation of whether this match was arrived at in the right way, then there seem to be two obvious approaches to construing justification: namely, in terms of the believer’s mind, or in terms of the world.

a. Internalism

Belief is a mental state, and belief-formation is a mental process. Accordingly, one might reason, whether or not a belief is justified – whether, that is, it is formed in the right way – can be determined by examining the thought-processes of the believer during its formation. Such a view, which maintains that justification depends solely on factors internal to the believer’s mind, is called internalism. (The term “internalism” has different meanings in other contexts; here, it will be used strictly to refer to this type of view about epistemic justification.)

According to internalism, the only factors that are relevant to the determination of whether a belief is justified are the believer’s other mental states. After all, an internalist will argue, only an individual’s mental states – her beliefs about the world, her sensory inputs (for example, her sense data) and her beliefs about the relations between her various beliefs – can determine what new beliefs she will form, so only an individual’s mental states can determine whether any particular belief is justified. In particular, in order to be justified, a belief must be appropriately based upon or supported by other mental states.

This raises the question of what constitutes the basing or support relation between a belief and one’s other mental states. We might want to say that, in order for belief A to be appropriately based on belief B (or beliefs B1 and B2, or B1, B2, and…Bn), the truth of B must suffice to establish the truth of A, in other words, B must entail A. (We shall consider the relationship between beliefs and sensory inputs below.) However, if we want to allow for our fallibility, we must instead say that the truth of B would give one good reason to believe that A is also true (by making it likely or probable that A is true). An elaboration of what counts as a good reason for belief, accordingly, is an essential part of any internalist account of justification.

However, there is an additional condition that we must add: belief B must itself be justified, since unjustified beliefs cannot confer justification on other beliefs. Because belief B be must also be justified, must there be some justified belief C upon which B is based? If so, C must itself be justified, and it may derive its justification from some further justified belief, D. This chain of beliefs deriving their justification from other beliefs may continue forever, leading us in an infinite regress. While the idea of an infinite regress might seem troubling, the primary ways of avoiding such a regress may have their own problems as well. This raises the “regress problem,” which begins from observing that there are only four possibilities as to the structure of one’s justified beliefs:

  1. The series of justified beliefs, each based upon the other, continues infinitely.
  2. The series of justified beliefs circles back to its beginning (A is based on B, B on C, C on D, and D on A).
  3. The series of justified beliefs begins with an unjustified belief.
  4. The series of justified beliefs begins with a belief which is justified, but not by virtue of being based on another justified belief.

These alternatives seem to exhaust the possibilities. That is, if one has any justified beliefs, one of these four possibilities must describe the relationships between those beliefs. As such, a complete internalist account of justification must decide among the four.

i. Foundationalism

Let us, then, consider each of the four possibilities mentioned above. Alternative 1 seems unacceptable because the human mind can contain only finitely many beliefs, and any thought-process that leads to the formation of a new belief must have some starting point. Alternative 2 seems no better, since circular reasoning appears to be fallacious. And alternative 3 has already been ruled out, since it renders the second belief in the series (and, thus, all subsequent beliefs) unjustified. That leaves alternative 4, which must, by process of elimination, be correct.

This line of reasoning, which is typically known as the regress argument, leads to the conclusion that there are two different kinds of justified beliefs: those which begin a series of justified beliefs, and those which are based on other justified beliefs. The former, called basic beliefs, are able to confer justification on other, non-basic beliefs, without themselves having their justification conferred upon them by other beliefs. As such, there is an asymmetrical relationship between basic and non-basic beliefs. Such a view of the structure of justified belief is known as “foundationalism.” In general, foundationalism entails that there is an asymmetrical relationship between any two beliefs: if A is based on B, then B cannot be based on A.

Accordingly, it follows that at least some beliefs (namely basic beliefs) are justified in some way other than by way of a relation to other beliefs. Basic beliefs must be self-justified, or must derive their justification from some non-doxastic source such as sensory inputs; the exact source of the justification of basic beliefs needs to be explained by any complete foundationalist account of justification.

ii. Coherentism

Internalists might be dissatisfied with foundationalism, since it allows for the possibility of beliefs that are justified without being based upon other beliefs. Since it was our solution to the regress problem that led us to foundationalism, and since none of the alternatives seem palatable, we might look for a flaw in the problem itself. Note that the problem is based on a pivotal but hitherto unstated assumption: namely, that justification is linear in fashion. That is, the statement of the regress problem assumes that the basing relation parallels a logical argument, with one belief being based on one or more other beliefs in an asymmetrical fashion.

So, an internalist who finds foundationalism to be problematic might deny this assumption, maintaining instead that justification is the result of a holistic relationship among beliefs. That is, one might maintain that beliefs derive their justification by inclusion in a set of beliefs which cohere with one another as a whole; a proponent of such a view is called a coherentist.

A coherentist, then, sees justification as a relation of mutual support among many beliefs, rather than a series of asymmetrical beliefs. A belief derives its justification, according to coherentism, not by being based on one or more other beliefs, but by virtue of its membership in a set of beliefs that all fit together in the right way. (The coherentist needs to specify what constitutes coherence, of course. It must be something more than logical consistency, since two unrelated beliefs may be consistent. Rather, there must be some positive support relationship – for instance, some sort of explanatory relationship – between the members of a coherent set in order for the beliefs to be individually justified.)

Coherentism is vulnerable to the “isolation objection”. It seems possible for a set of beliefs to be coherent, but for all of those beliefs to be isolated from reality. Consider, for instance, a work of fiction. All of the statements in the work of fiction might form a coherent set, but presumably believing all and only the statements in a work of fiction will not render one justified. Indeed, any form of internalism seems vulnerable to this objection, and thus a complete internalist account of justification must address it. Recall that justification requires a match between one’s mind and the world, and an inordinate emphasis on the relations between the beliefs in one’s mind seems to ignore the question of whether those beliefs match up with the way things actually are.

b. Externalism

Accordingly, one might think that focusing solely on factors internal to the believer’s mind will inevitably lead to a mistaken account of justification. The alternative, then, is that at least some factors external to the believer’s mind determine whether or not she is justified. A proponent of such a view is called an externalist.

According to externalism, the only way to avoid the isolation objection and ensure that knowledge does not include luck is to consider some factors other than the individual’s other beliefs. Which factors, then, should be considered? The most prominent version of externalism, called reliabilism, suggests that we consider the source of a belief. Beliefs can be formed as a result of many different sources, such as sense experience, reason, testimony, memory. More precisely, we might specify which sense was used, who provided the testimony, what sort of reasoning is used, or how recent the relevant memory is. For every belief, we can indicate the cognitive process that led to its formation. In its simplest and most straightforward form, reliabilism maintains that whether or not a belief is justified depends upon whether that process is a reliable source of true beliefs. Since we are seeking a match between our mind and the world, justified beliefs are those which result from processes which regularly achieve such a match. So, for example, using vision to determine the color of an object which is well-lit and relatively near is a reliable belief-forming process for a person with normal vision, but not for a color-blind person. Forming beliefs on the basis of the testimony of an expert is likely to yield true beliefs, but forming beliefs on the basis of the testimony of compulsive liars is not. In general, if a belief is the result of a cognitive process which reliably (most of the time – we still want to leave room for human fallibility) leads to true beliefs, then that belief is justified.

The foregoing suggests one immediate challenge for reliabilism. The formation of a belief is a one-time event, but the reliability of the process depends upon the long-term performance of that process. (This can include counterfactual as well as actual events. For instance, a coin which is flipped only once and lands on heads nonetheless has a 50% chance of landing on tails, even though its actual performance has yielded heads 100% of the time.) And this requires that we specify which process is being used, so that we can evaluate its performance in other instances. However, cognitive processes can be described in more or less general terms: for example, the same belief-forming process might be variously described as sense experience, vision, vision by a normally-sighted person, vision by a normally-sighted person in daylight, vision by a normally-sighted person in daylight while looking at a tree, vision by a normally-sighted person in daylight while looking at an elm tree, and so forth. The “generality problem” notes that some of these descriptions might specify a reliable process but others might specify an unreliable process, so that we cannot know whether a belief is justified or unjustified unless we know the appropriate level of generality to use in describing the process.

Even if the generality problem can be solved, another problem remains for externalism. Keith Lehrer presents this problem by way of his example of Mr. Truetemp. Truetemp has, unbeknownst to him, had a tempucomp – a device which accurately reads the temperature and causes a spontaneous belief about that temperature – implanted in his brain. As a result, he has many true beliefs about the temperature, but he does not know why he has them or what their source is. Lehrer argues that, although Truetemp’s belief-forming process is reliable, his ignorance of the tempucomp renders his temperature-beliefs unjustified, and thus that a reliable cognitive process cannot yield justification unless the believer is aware of the fact that the process is reliable. In other words, the mere fact that the process is reliable does not suffice, Lehrer concludes, to justify any beliefs which are formed via that process.

4. The Extent of Human Knowledge

a. Sources of Knowledge

Given the above characterization of knowledge, there are many ways that one might come to know something. Knowledge of empirical facts about the physical world will necessarily involve perception, in other words, the use of the senses. Science, with its collection of data and conducting of experiments, is the paradigm of empirical knowledge. However, much of our more mundane knowledge comes from the senses, as we look, listen, smell, touch, and taste the various objects in our environments.

But all knowledge requires some amount of reasoning. Data collected by scientists must be analyzed before knowledge is yielded, and we draw inferences based on what our senses tell us. And knowledge of abstract or non-empirical facts will exclusively rely upon reasoning. In particular, intuition is often believed to be a sort of direct access to knowledge of the a priori.

Once knowledge is obtained, it can be sustained and passed on to others. Memory allows us to know something that we knew in the past, even, perhaps, if we no longer remember the original justification. Knowledge can also be transmitted from one individual to another via testimony; that is, my justification for a particular belief could amount to the fact that some trusted source has told me that it is true.

b. Skepticism

In addition to the nature of knowledge, epistemologists concern themselves with the question of the extent of human knowledge: how much do we, or can we, know? Whatever turns out to be the correct account of the nature of knowledge, there remains the matter of whether we actually have any knowledge. It has been suggested that we do not, or cannot, know anything, or at least that we do not know as much as we think we do. Such a view is called skepticism.

We can distinguish between a number of different varieties of skepticism. First, one might be a skeptic only with regard to certain domains, such as mathematics, morality, or the external world (this is the most well-known variety of skepticism). Such a skeptic is a local skeptic, as contrasted with a global skeptic, who maintains that we cannot know anything at all. Also, since knowledge requires that our beliefs be both true and justified, a skeptic might maintain that none of our beliefs are true or that none of them are justified (the latter is much more common than the former).

While it is quite easy to challenge any claim to knowledge by glibly asking, “How do you know?”, this does not suffice to show that skepticism is an important position. Like any philosophical stance, skepticism must be supported by an argument. Many arguments have been offered in defense of skepticism, and many responses to those arguments have been offered in return. Here, we shall consider two of the most prominent arguments in support of skepticism about the external world.

c. Cartesian Skepticism

In the first of his Meditations, René Descartes offers an argument in support of skepticism, which he then attempts to refute in the later Meditations. The argument notes that some of our perceptions are inaccurate. Our senses can trick us; we sometimes mistake a dream for a waking experience, and it is possible that an evil demon is systematically deceiving us. (The modern version of the evil demon scenario is that you are a brain-in-a-vat, because scientists have removed your brain from your skull, connected it to a sophisticated computer, and immersed it in a vat of preservative fluid. The computer produces what seem to be genuine sense experiences, and also responds to your brain’s output to make it seem that you are able to move about in your environment as you did when your brain was still in your body. While this scenario may seem far-fetched, we must admit that it is at least possible.)

As a result, some of our beliefs will be false. In order to be justified in believing what we do, we must have some way to distinguish between those beliefs which are true (or, at least, are likely to be true) and those which are not. But just as there are no signs that will allow us to distinguish between waking and dreaming, there are no signs that will allow us to distinguish between beliefs that are accurate and beliefs which are the result of the machinations of an evil demon. This indistinguishability between trustworthy and untrustworthy belief, the argument goes, renders all of our beliefs unjustified, and thus we cannot know anything. A satisfactory response to this argument, then, must show either that we are indeed able to distinguish between true and false beliefs, or that we need not be able to make such a distinction.

d. Humean Skepticism

According to the indistinguishability skeptic, my senses can tell me how things appear, but not how they actually are. We need to use reason to construct an argument that leads us from beliefs about how things appear to (justified) beliefs about how they are. But even if we are able to trust our perceptions, so that we know that they are accurate, David Hume argues that the specter of skepticism remains. Note that we only perceive a very small part of the universe at any given moment, although we think that we have knowledge of the world beyond that which we are currently perceiving. It follows, then, that the senses alone cannot account for this knowledge, and that reason must supplement the senses in some way in order to account for any such knowledge. However, Hume argues, reason is incapable of providing justification for any belief about the external world beyond the scope of our current sense perceptions. Let us consider two such possible arguments and Hume’s critique of them.

i. Numerical vs. Qualitative Identity

We typically believe that the external world is, for the most part, stable. For instance, I believe that my car is parked where I left it this morning, even though I am not currently looking at it. If I were to go peek out the window right now and see my car, I might form the belief that my car has been in the same space all day. What is the basis for this belief? If asked to make my reasoning explicit, I might proceed as follows:

I have had two sense-experiences of my car: one this morning and one just now.
The two sense-experiences were (more or less) identical.
Therefore, it is likely that the objects that caused them are identical.
Therefore, a single object – my car – has been in that parking space all day.

Similar reasoning would undergird all of our beliefs about the persistence of the external world and all of the objects we perceive. But are these beliefs justified? Hume thinks not, since the above argument (and all arguments like it) contains an equivocation. In particular, the first occurrence of “identical” refers to qualitative identity. The two sense-experiences are not one and the same, but are distinct; when we say that they are identical we mean that one is similar to the other in all of its qualities or properties. But the second occurrence of “identical” refers to numerical identity. When we say that the objects that caused the two sense-experiences are identical, we mean that there is one object, rather than two, that is responsible for both of them. This equivocation, Hume argues, renders the argument fallacious; accordingly, we need another argument to support our belief that objects persist even when we are not observing them.

ii. Hume’s Skepticism about Induction

Suppose that a satisfactory argument could be found in support of our beliefs in the persistence of physical objects. This would provide us with knowledge that the objects that we have observed have persisted even when we were not observing them. But in addition to believing that these objects have persisted up until now, we believe that they will persist in the future; we also believe that objects we have never observed similarly have persisted and will persist. In other words, we expect the future to be roughly like the past, and the parts of the universe that we have not observed to be roughly like the parts that we have observed. For example, I believe that my car will persist into the future. What is the basis for this belief? If asked to make my reasoning explicit, I might proceed as follows:

My car has always persisted in the past.
Nature is roughly uniform across time and space (and thus the future will be roughly like the past).
Therefore, my car will persist in the future.

Similar reasoning would undergird all of our beliefs about the future and about the unobserved. Are such beliefs justified? Again, Hume thinks not, since the above argument, and all arguments like it, contain an unsupported premise, namely the second premise, which might be called the Principle of the Uniformity of Nature (PUN). Why should we believe this principle to be true? Hume insists that we provide some reason in support of this belief. Because the above argument is an inductive rather than a deductive argument, the problem of showing that it is a good argument is typically referred to as the “problem of induction.” We might think that there is a simple and straightforward solution to the problem of induction, and that we can indeed provide support for our belief that PUN is true. Such an argument would proceed as follows:

PUN has always been true in the past.
Nature is roughly uniform across time and space (and thus the future will be roughly like the past).
Therefore, PUN will be true in the future.

This argument, however, is circular; its second premise is PUN itself! Accordingly, we need another argument to support our belief that PUN is true, and thus to justify our inductive arguments about the future and the unobserved.

5. Conclusion

The study of knowledge is one of the most fundamental aspects of philosophical inquiry. Any claim to knowledge must be evaluated to determine whether or not it indeed constitutes knowledge. Such an evaluation essentially requires an understanding of what knowledge is and how much knowledge is possible. While this article provides on overview of the important issues, it leaves the most basic questions unanswered; epistemology will continue to be an area of philosophical discussion as long as these questions remain.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Alston, William P., 1989. Epistemic Justification: Essays in the Theory of Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Armstrong, David, 1973. Belief, Truth, and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • A defense of reliabilism.
  • BonJour, Laurence, 1985. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
    • A defense of coherentism.
  • Chisholm, Roderick, 1966. Theory of Knowledge, Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
  • Chisholm, Roderick, 1977. Theory of Knowledge, 2nd edition. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
  • Chisholm, Roderick, 1989. Theory of Knowledge, 3rd edition. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
    • Chisholm was one of the first authors to provide a systematic analysis of knowledge. His account of justification is foundationalist.
  • Descartes, Rene, 1641. Meditations on First Philosophy. Reprinted in The Philosophical Writings of Descartes (3 volumes). Cottingham, Stoothoff and Murdoch, trans. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Descartes presents an infallibilist version of foundationalism, and attempts to refute skepticism.
  • Dancy, Jonathan and Ernest Sosa (eds.), 1993. A Companion to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • DeRose, Keith, 1995. “Solving the Skeptical Problem” Philosophical Review, 104, pp. 1-52.
  • DeRose Keith and Ted Warfield (eds.), 1999. Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Feldman, Richard and Earl Conee, 1985. “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies, 48, pp. 15-34.
    • The authors present and defend an (internalist) account of justification according to which a belief is justified or unjustified in virtue of the believer’s evidence.
  • Gettier, Edmund, 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis, 23, pp. 121-123.
    • In which the Gettier problem is introduced.
  • Goldman, Alvin, 1976. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” Journal of Philosophy, 64, pp. 357-372.
  • Goldman, Alvin, 1986. Epistemology and Cognition. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
    • Perhaps the most important defense of reliabilism.
  • Haack, Susan, 1991. “A Foundherentist Theory of Empirical Justification,” In Theory of Knowledge: Classical and Contemporary Sources (3rd ed.), Pojman, Louis (ed.), Belmont, CA: Wadsworth.
    • An attempt to combine coherentism and foundationalism into an internalist account of justification which is superior to either of the two.
  • Hume, David, 1739. A Treatise on Human Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Hume, David, 1751. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Lehrer, Keith, 2000. Theory of Knowledge (2nd ed.). Boulder, CO: Westview.
    • A defense of coherentism. This is also where we find the Truetemp example.
  • Lehrer, Keith and Stewart Cohen, 1983. “Justification, Truth, and Coherence.” Synthese, 55, pp. 191-207.
  • Lewis, David, 1996. “Elusive Knowledge” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 74, pp. 549-567.
  • Locke, John, 1689. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Oxford: Clarendon.
  • Plato, Meno and Theaetetus. In Complete Works. J. Cooper, ed. Indianapolis: Hackett.
    • Plato presents and defends a version of the JTB analysis of knowledge.
  • Pollock, John and Joseph Cruz, 1999. Contemporary Theories of Knowledge (2nd ed.). Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield.
    • A defense of non-doxastic foundationalism, in which the basic states are percepts rather than beliefs.
  • Russell, Bertrand, 1912. Problems of Philosophy.
    • Russell presents a Gettier-type example, which was largely overlooked for many years.

Author Information

David A. Truncellito
Email: truncell@aya.yale.edu
U. S. A.

Political Obligation

Why should I obey the law? Apart from the obvious prudential and self-interested reasons (to avoid punishment, loss of reputation, and so forth), is there a moral obligation to do what the law requires just because the law requires it? If the answer is yes and the mere illegality of an act renders its performance prima facie morally wrong, then I am under a political obligation. Political obligation thus refers to the moral duty of citizens to obey the laws of their state. In cases where an act or forbearance that is required by law is morally obligatory on independent grounds, political obligation simply gives the citizen an additional reason for acting accordingly. But law tends to extend beyond morality, forbidding otherwise morally innocent behavior and compelling acts and omissions that are discretionary from an independent moral point of view. In such cases, the sole source of one’s moral duty to comply with the law is his or her political obligation.

Theories of political obligation can be roughly divided into three camps: transactional accounts, natural duty, and associative theories.

Table of Contents

  1. Transactional Accounts
    1. Fairness
    2. Gratitude
    3. Consent
  2. Natural Duty
    1. Utilitarianism
    2. Rights-Protecting Institutions
  3. Associative Theories
  4. Mixed Accounts
  5. Sensitivity to Regime Type
  6. Relationship to Legitimate Authority
  7. The Weight of Political Obligation
  8. Philosophical Anarchism
  9. References and Further Reading

1. Transactional Accounts

Transactional accounts suggest that political obligation is acquired through some morally significant transaction between the citizen and his compatriots or between the citizen and his state.” Three such theories can be distinguished.

a. Fairness

A political community is a cooperative scheme that is geared towards the production of benefits for its members: security, transport, clean water, and so forth. The venture is fruitful in producing these benefits because those participating observe certain restrictions and pay their taxes. To enjoy the benefits of the scheme without submitting to its restrictions is to free-ride on the sacrifices of others, which is unfair. The demands of fairness thus yield political obligation. H.L.A Hart was among the first to articulate this account:

When a number of persons conduct any joint enterprise according to rules and thus restrict their liberty, those who have submitted to those restrictions when required have a right to a similar submission from those who have benefited by their submission. (Hart, 1955: 185)

There are some difficulties with citing fairness as the source of political obligation. Robert Nozick introduces the following thought experiment in Anarchy, State and Utopia. Suppose that a group of your neighbors invest in a public address system and decide to launch a program of public entertainment. They list the names of all of the people in the neighborhood, numbering 365 in total.

On his assigned day a person is to run the public address system, play records over it, give news bulletins, tell amusing stories he has heard, and so on. After 138 days on which each person has done his part, your day arrives. Are you obligated to take your turn? You have benefited from it… but must you answer the call when it is your turn to do so? (Nozick, 1974: 93)

The answer seems to be no. From this Nozick draws the conclusion that one does not acquire an obligation to cooperate with a scheme simply by benefiting from its labors. But examples that produce contrasting intuitions come readily to mind. Suppose that the residents of Nozick’s neighborhood vote to dig a public well, to be paid for and maintained by the members of the neighborhood, as an alternative to tap water that is dangerously polluted. One resident, who feels that the well is completely unnecessary, refuses to have anything to do with the enterprise. The others nevertheless proceed to dig the well and fund its maintenance and, after a fortnight, the dissenter begins to take water from the well. In this case, the dissenter has acquired an obligation to pitch in or to contribute his fair share.

The relevant difference between the two cases is whether the benefits are merely received or positively accepted. In Nozick’s example the benefits of the scheme are simply foisted upon all members of the neighborhood, who have no real choice over whether or not they will receive them. The benefits can be avoided, but not without great inconvenience. One would have to go to great lengths to avoid enjoying the music and entertainment being churned out through the public address system. In the latter case, the dissenter must go out of his way to retrieve water from the public well. Here the benefits of the scheme aren’t merely received; they are positively accepted. This makes all the difference. While the acceptance of a scheme’s benefits may be enough to generate an obligation of fair play, their mere receipt cannot (Simmons 1979: 125-28).

The problem with generalizing from this example is that most of the benefits provided by the state are “open” goods, the enjoyment of which simply cannot be avoided, at least not without great inconvenience. The peaceful and secure environment created by police, roads, and national defense are all cases in point. Since we cannot say that these benefits are “accepted,” it is difficult to maintain that those who enjoy them incur a political obligation of fair play by so doing. Those citizens that take advantage of the readily available but not “open” benefits that society makes available, such as emergency services upon request, may incur a duty to requite, but this cannot give us a sufficiently general account of political obligation (Simmons, 1979: 127-28).

But is “acceptance” always necessary? According to George Klosko, the “mere receipt” of a benefit fails to impose a duty to reciprocate only when the benefit in question is trivial. The force of the argument is blunted once we turn away from “discretionary” benefits that are not essential to well-being, such as entertainment, and towards “presumptive” benefits: goods that are necessary for an acceptable life such that all persons can reasonably be presumed to want them (Klosko 1987: 246). Klosko lists “physical security, protection from a hostile environment, and the satisfaction of basic bodily needs,” offering the following example to illustrate his point: A lives in a small territory surrounded by hostile territories whose leaders have made public their intention to slaughter the citizens of X. In order to defend themselves, the X-ites must band together and institute measures such as compulsory military service. A, however, finds this too burdensome and time consuming and decides not to comply. Although the mutual-protection scheme has simply sprung up around him, we feel that it is wrong for A to free ride on the sacrifices of his fellow X-ites. He must reciprocate for the safety and security that he enjoys because of their efforts (Klosko 1987: 249). From this, Klosko infers that the mere receipt of “presumptive” benefits is enough to create a duty of fair play.

But now the emphasis has shifted from the enjoyment of benefits to the importance of the goods provided. This gives us reason to suspect that considerations of fair play are not ultimately what ground political obligation on Klosko’s picture. Rather an independent imperative to help supply essential goods to one’s compatriots – a “natural duty” – may be what is doing the work (Wellman and Simmons 2005: 189-90). Natural duty theories will be considered in greater detail below.

b. Gratitude

According to this account, a citizen owes a debt of gratitude to the government for the benefits that it provides. This debt is owed regardless of whether these benefits are accepted or merely received, and the debt is repaid through obedience to law.

There are a number of obvious difficulties with this account. First, only a benefactor who makes a special effort or sacrifice is owed a debt of gratitude (Simmons 1979: 170). But public benefits are taxpayer-funded and members of government are paid handsomely for their work. As such, no sacrifice by the government is present. Our fellow citizens collectively do make sacrifices from which we benefit, but insofar as they are compelled to do so, they cannot be the objects of a debt of gratitude. Voluntary benefaction is necessary for any such debt to arise. Furthermore, gratitude is not owed for benefaction that is motivated by malice or self-interest, which means that a government is not owed obedience for services that it provides only to win votes, to improve its reputation in international circles, or for other such disqualifying reasons.

Second, even the concession that citizens owe a debt of gratitude to their government cannot salvage this account, for the content of this debt remains an open question. In other words, it is not clear that the debt must be repaid through obedience, rather than in some other way. Interjecting that this is what governments ask for in return is unsatisfactory since, as Simmons points out, “benefactors are not specially entitled to themselves specify what shall constitute a fitting return for their benefaction” (Simmons, 2002: 34).

c. Consent

On this theory, a citizen that freely consents to his government’s authority binds himself to obedience. Though few deny this, the difficulty with consent theory is identifying an action in the personal history of most individuals that might count as a valid token of consent.

Residence in a government’s territory was said to express “tacit” consent by Locke and Rousseau (Locke, 1690: ch. 8, Rousseau, 1762: IV, ii). The fatal errors of this view are well documented. For an act or omission to register consent, the agent performing it must be aware of the moral significance of what he is doing. One cannot submit to authority and be bound unknowingly (Simmons, 1979: 64). Furthermore, the agent must have the opportunity to withhold consent and doing so must not come at too great a personal cost (otherwise consent cannot be considered free and voluntary). Residence fails to meet each of these criteria. First, if occupying territory expresses consent to the authority of its government, it is safe to say that the greater bulk of citizens in any country are not aware of it. Second, the only way to withhold consent on this view is to emigrate, which is impossible for some and possible but extremely costly for others. Even if the moral significance of residence were known to all, in many cases it would still not be free and voluntary, which consent must be in order to bind – a point articulated by David Hume in “On the Social Contract:”

Can we seriously say that a poor peasant or artisan has a free choice to leave his country, when he knows no foreign language or manners, and lives from day to day, by the small wages which he acquires? (Hume, 1748)

A popular alternative token of consent is that of democratic participation or voting. Weak and strong formulations of democratic consent theory can be distinguished. According to the weak version, to vote for a candidate in a democratic election is to consent to his appointment to a position of political authority and therefore to bind oneself to obedience should that candidate’s bid for power be successful. The strong version states that by participating in a democratic election fully aware that the purpose of the procedure is to invest authority in the candidate that wins the most votes, one consents to the procedure as a way of determining who will wield political power and therefore agrees to be bound by its outcome whichever way it goes. Under this alternative, a democratically elected government is owed obedience by every citizen that partook in the election by which it was empowered.

But every democratic country contains citizens that are, for whatever reason, unable or unwilling to vote. This leaves a large portion of any democratic populace unbound by the duty to obey the law, even on the stronger formulation of democratic consent theory. By identifying voting as our token of consent, we avoid the difficulties associated with the residence account, but are left with a theory of political obligation that is insufficiently general in its scope.

2. Natural Duty

According to natural duty theories, political obligation is grounded not in a morally significant transaction that takes place between citizens and polity, but either 1) in the importance of advancing some impartial moral good, such as utility or justice; or 2) in a moral duty owed by all persons to all others regardless of their transactional history.

a. Utilitarianism

Unlike the theories previously discussed, a utilitarian account of political obligation is forward rather than backward looking, deriving political obligation from the future goods to be produced by obedience, rather than from what citizens have done in the past or what has been done for them. Utilitarianism posits that actions that maximize utility are morally required. Utility is maximized by acts that produce more (or at least as much) happiness and well-being than any alternative course of action that is open to the agent. The duty to obey the law is derived from this: since obedience produces more happiness than disobedience, one must obey.

One of the more interesting utilitarian accounts of political obligation is developed by R.M. Hare. The acts and forbearances that are required of us by law are generally acts that are conducive to the greatest happiness of the greatest number independently of their being required by law. Even in a lawless “state of nature,” the imperative to maximize utility would surely enjoin that we not burgle, assault, or murder our neighbors. But the mere fact that the law requires something generates additional utilitarian reasons for complying according to Hare. He argues that the promulgation and enforcement of a law requiring X increases or amplifies the utility of X-ing and the disutility of refusing or failing to X. There are several ways that it can do this.

First, some actions only produce good consequences when performed in coordination with others. The enforcement of law helps to bring this about. Hare offers the following example. Grant that we are each under a utilitarian obligation to observe clean habits in order to prevent the spread of typhus. Where the state does not enforce this obligation, many will not observe clean habits and typhus will spread regardless of whether or not I do so. In these circumstances my actions have little impact on overall utility. But once a corresponding law is passed and obedience is widely enforced, my failure to delouse myself jeopardizes the successful containment of the disease. The enactment and enforcement of a law thus adds to my pre-existing utilitarian obligation to observe hygiene standards by making it more likely that this will be effective in preventing the spread of typhus.

But this cannot be said for all acts and forbearances. Some seem to have the same utility whether or not they are widely enforced. In these cases, Hare appeals to more mundane considerations to support his conclusion. Laws require enforcement and their transgression demands punishment. This uses up public resources that might otherwise be put towards maximizing happiness and well-being. Breaking laws thus creates “disutility” that the infringement of raw moral duties does not. The mere illegality of an act gives us an independent utilitarian reason to refrain from it (Hare, 1989: 14).

But even if the utility of obedience is enhanced by factors such as these, there will surely still be some occasions on which disobedience would clearly produce more utility all things considered. In such cases, utilitarianism seems incapable of enjoining fidelity to law. This is a problem because, while all duties are prima facie and liable to be overridden by countervailing moral considerations, a moral requirement that gives way in the face of very slight utility gains hardly seems to be an obligation in any meaningful sense of the word (Simmons 1979: 49). Rule-utilitarianism looks more promising in this respect. On this view, what is required is conformity to rules that are justified on utilitarian grounds; that is, rules which maximize utility when complied with generally.  “Obey the law” does seem to be such a rule on the face of it. But if an alternative rule could be identified which would produce even better consequences, then it must supplant the rule “obey the law” according to rule-utilitarianism. And there does seem to be such a rule, namely; obey the law except when disobedience would certainly have better consequences. This takes us back to square one.

b. Rights-Protecting Institutions

Political obligation might alternatively be derived from the natural duties that human rights impose on us. The theory developed by Allen Buchanan in “Political Legitimacy and Democracy” (2002) will serve as an example. To show adequate respect for human rights, it is not enough to refrain from violating them. We must also do what we can to ensure that they are not violated by others, at least when we can do so without sustaining too high a personal cost. This is not a duty that we possess by virtue of having committed ourselves to protecting others. We have it “naturally,” regardless of what we have done in the past or what has been done for us. (Buchanan, 2002: 707).

Obedience helps to ensure that the state functions effectively. If the state does a credible job of protecting the human rights of its citizens, obedience helps to ensure that the human rights of one’s compatriots are protected. To refuse to obey constitutes a refusal to do what one can to protect human rights, which is a transgression of one’s natural duty. Thus, political obligation is among the moral requirements that the human rights of others naturally impose on us.

A major shortcoming of this account, and of all natural duty theories, is their inability to bind individuals to one particular political authority above all others. (This is referred to in the literature as the “problem of particularity.”) A duty to promote justice, utility, or human rights might give a citizen reason to obey and support his own state, but it equally gives him reason to support just and competent states abroad. And if utility, justice, or human rights would be better served by putting the demands of a foreign state ahead of one’s own, then this would seem to be the right thing to do. The money I spend on taxes, for example, would probably do more for justice and human rights if it were instead donated to a poor, developing country, in which case the best way to discharge my natural duty would involve tax evasion.

3. Associative Theories

According to associative accounts, a citizen is duty-bound to obey the law simply by virtue of his or her membership in a political community. In many cases, we are willing to concede that the non-voluntary occupation of a social role comes with moral duties attached. The duties of neighbors, friends, and family are all cases in point. (A daughter owes her parents honor and respect simply because she is their daughter, independently of whatever debt of gratitude she may have accrued). Likewise, political associations are “pregnant of obligation,” such that occupying the role of a “citizen” within such an association comes with its own set of duties, including a duty to obey the law (Dworkin 1986: 206). We simply misunderstand what it means to be a member of a political society if we think that political obligation needs any further justification. (McPherson 1967: 64). Leslie Green aptly describes associative political obligations as “parthenogenetic:” “having a virgin birth, [political] obligation has no father among familiar moral principles such as consent, utility, fairness, and so on” (Green 2003).

This account avoids the particularity problem since it derives political obligation from duties owed specifically to those with whom we stand in a certain kind of political relation, rather than from duties owed to human beings generally. But it is open to other kinds of objections. Even if we accept that there are associative obligations within families and between friends, we might say that the typical political association lacks morally relevant characteristics possessed by the typical family or friendship (e.g. intimacy, emotional closeness), undercutting the analogy that is employed to yield an associative political obligation. “Associativists are united in emphasizing the ‘Uncle’ in ‘Uncle Sam’” writes Wellman. “The obvious problem for this approach is that citizens are not connected to compatriots as they are to uncles” (Wellman 1997: 200).

Or we might allow that families and political associations are relevantly similar, but simply reject the notion of associative obligations. Wellman maintains that associative bonds, allegiances, and attachments may give rise to special responsibilities, but denies that these are tantamount to moral duties (Wellman 1997: 186). We are asked to consider a sibling that decides not to attend his sister’s wedding just because he would rather spend his time and money elsewhere. We may disapprove of this individual given his lack of concern for his sister’s life. But we do not feel that he has failed to do something that his sister has a right against him that he do; we do not feel that he has failed to discharge a duty (Wellman 1997: 186). His behavior is unsavory, but it is not unjust; and if familial ties do not ground special, associative obligations, neither do political associations.

4. Mixed Accounts

Mixed accounts combine elements of two or more of the theories so far discussed. A recent example is Christopher Wellman’s “Samaritan” theory, which derives political obligation from the natural duties of citizens together with their obligations of fair play.

The fist part of Wellman’s theory is not dissimilar to Buchanan’s account, which was sketched above. States depend on widespread obedience to function effectively. An effectively functioning state is necessary to protect people from the dangers inherent in the state of nature. Obedience to the state is therefore necessary to ensure that others are protected from peril. This, Wellman insists, is something that we each have a natural “Samaritan” duty to do. This is the natural duty aspect of Wellman’s account. But obviously the state does not depend on the obedience of each and every citizen 100% of the time in order to function effectively. The non-compliance of a few in the midst of general compliance does not compromise the state’s ability to protect its citizens from the dangers of the state of nature. This presents us with a problem. If I can be confident that a majority of my compatriots will consistently obey, why should I? The state will continue to fulfill its protective function regardless of what I do and no one’s safety is jeopardized by my infidelity to law. It seems that by disobeying, I am not doing anything that is inconsistent with my Samaritan duty to defend others from peril.

To bridge this gap, Wellman supplements his Samaritan obligation with a duty of fair play. Contributing one’s fair share to the achievement of the Samaritan objective – defending others from peril – requires obedience even when disobedience would seem to be inconsequential. It would be unfair to shirk one’s share of the “Samaritan chore” (Wellman 2004: 749).

The trouble with mixed accounts is that they seem prone to inherit the difficulties associated with the theories of which they are composed. Complementing a natural duty with a principle of fairness does not, for example, cause the “problem of particularity” to disappear. Rather, the problem seems to carry over and contaminate Wellman’s mixed theory. (Why do I have a duty to contribute a fair share to the “Samaritan chore” in my own community, rather than in some foreign state?) Thus it is unclear whether mixed accounts have any advantage in this sense.

5. Sensitivity to Regime Type

Whether liberal democracy is a precondition of political obligation depends on which of the above theories we apply. The gratitude account does not appear to preclude citizens owing obedience to undemocratic and tyrannical regimes. To be sure, the depth of one’s debt of gratitude depends on the extent to which he or she benefits, so it is safe to say that democratic citizens will typically owe more than authoritarian subjects by way of requital. Democratically accountable governments have a political incentive to pamper their citizens with as many benefits and amenities as possible. Furthermore, a subject that is denied the rights and liberties afforded to his democratic counterparts has less to be grateful for. Nevertheless the subjects of authoritarian governments might still enjoy substantial benefits thanks to their state – stable employment, security against crime, foreign invasion, and so forth. – and as long as they do, they owe a debt of gratitude and therefore political obligation.

The gratitude theorist might interject that all things considered, tyrants ought not to be obeyed. The injustices perpetrated by such regimes ought to be resisted even if this means failing to repay one’s debt of gratitude. But this does not deny that political obligation is owed to tyrants; it merely concedes that political obligation is prima facie and can sometimes be overridden by countervailing moral considerations. While the gratitude account can in this way be supplemented so as to avoid extending to the oppressed an all things considered duty to obey, the important point is that it cannot confine prima facie political obligation to the citizens of liberal democracies.

On the face of it, it would seem that fairness theory’s sensitivity to regime type is no different from that of the gratitude account. Insofar as democratic citizens typically receive more benefits, what constitutes a “fair share” for them to contribute in return might be more than what non-democratic citizens owe. But the latter are still bound to reciprocate for the goods that they do enjoy.

But A.J. Simmons denies that this is the case. “Fair play” obligations, he says, can only arise in a liberal democratic setting:

Only political communities which at least appear to be reasonably democratic will be candidates for a “fair play account” to begin with. For only where we can see the political workings of the society as a voluntary, cooperative venture will the principle apply. Thus, a theorist who holds that the acceptance of benefits from a cooperative scheme is the only ground of political obligation, will be forced to admit that in at least a large number of nations, no citizens have political obligations (Simmons 1979: 136-37).

The claim here is not that we are only obliged to discharge our duties of fair play if we happen to live in a democracy, but that prima facie duties of fair play cannot even arise in states that aren’t liberal democratic (Simmons 1979: 136-37). Simmons’ remarks, however, seem wrongheaded. What characteristics must a society possess in order to count as a “voluntary, cooperative venture?” Presumably, those participating would have to do so of their own free will, which is tantamount to saying that their involvement must be consensual. Now when Simmons says that a society must be a voluntary cooperative enterprise for the fairness account to have purchase, he surely cannot mean that only where every member of a society is a voluntary participant can fairness be invoked to yield political obligation. For not even liberal democracies will meet this standard. More importantly, if a society did manage to meet this standard, the fairness principle would become redundant: everybody would be under a political obligation simply by virtue of having consented to participate in the scheme. Hence Simmons can only mean that a society must contain a core enterprise that is voluntary and cooperative, made up of consenting participants, which makes benefits available to those outside the core and thus binds them to reciprocate even though they aren’t voluntary participants. But in this case he cannot plausibly maintain that it is only possible for liberal democracies to satisfy this condition, for authoritarian societies also seem to contain a core of voluntary participants cooperating and making benefits available to the rest.

Is liberal democracy necessary for political obligation on consent theory? At first glance, the answer appears to depend on the token of consent identified. Where consent is registered by voting, then clearly a society must be democratic in order for its citizens to be under a political obligation. On the other hand if consent is expressed through mere residence, it would seem that the denial of rights and liberties – free speech, democracy, and so forth – has no bearing on the issue of consent and political obligation.

But closer inspection reveals that this is mistaken. Consent is only morally binding if expressed under the right conditions, whichever form it happens to take, a point alluded to by John Rawls in A Theory of Justice: “it is generally agreed that extorted promises are void ab initio. But similarly, unjust social arrangements are themselves a kind of extortion, even violence, and consent to them does not bind” (Rawls, 1971: 343). Rawls’ conclusion is correct, but his reasoning here is faulty. The voluntariness of consent is not necessarily undermined by the injustice of the state consented to, particularly if the consenter is not himself the target of oppression. But we can plausibly raise doubts as to whether consent, however it is registered, is fully informed when given to an unjust state, which seems to be the route taken by Michael Walzer:

It is not enough that particularly striking acts of consent be free; the whole of our moral lives must be free so that we can freely prepare to consent, argue about consenting, intimate our consent to other men and women… Civil liberty of the most extensive sort is, therefore, the necessary condition of political obligation and just government. Liberty must be as extensive as the possible range of consenting action – over time and through political space – if citizens can conceivably be bound to a strict obedience (Walzer, 1970: xii).

Thus one could say that regardless of the token of consent identified, its validity is conditional upon liberal democratic institutions.

Finally, let us turn to natural duty theories. On the utilitarian account, wherever obedience would generate more happiness and well-being than disobedience, this is what morality requires. Thus if we had some reason to believe that obedience maximizes utility in democratic countries and fails to do so everywhere else, only then would the utilitarian say that democracy is a necessary condition of political obligation. However this empirical premise seems somewhat farfetched.

The natural duty to promote justice, on the other hand, extends political obligation only to the citizens of “reasonably just” states, according to Rawls, or states where each person has an equal right to the most extensive set of liberties compatible with a similar set of liberties for others. This demands stringent protection of basic human rights such as personal security, as well as of property rights, freedom of conscience, freedom of speech and association, and so on. Also, all citizens are to be afforded some kind of democratic participation. Therefore, the duty to promote justice only entails an obligation to obey liberal democracies. The subjects of other kinds of regimes might be said to have a duty to comply only when their so doing would “assist in the establishment of just arrangements” (Rawls 1971: 334), but not a general, content-independent political obligation owed to their state. Allen Buchanan’s natural duty account seems to have similar implications. On Buchanan’s theory, the duty to obey the law is grounded in the natural duty to make rights-protecting institutions available to others. It follows that “failed” states that do not competently fulfill this protective function and illiberal regimes that actually trample on human rights themselves cannot be owed obedience.

6. Relationship to Legitimate Authority

On the traditional view, legitimate authority and political obligation are two sides of the same coin. A state is “legitimate” in the sense of having a right to issue and enforce directives if and only if its citizens are under a political obligation. If citizens do not have a prima facie obligation to obey the law, their government does not have a right to promulgate and enforce it (Simmons 1979: 195).

There are, however, alternative accounts that decouple political obligation from legitimate authority. Kent Greenawalt, for example, argues that a legitimate government’s “justification right” – its right to make and enforce law – implies a duty of non-interference on the part of the citizenry, but not a duty to obey (Greenawalt, 1999). However, if what is meant by “interference” is interference with the state’s regulation of society, it is not clear that interference and disobedience can coherently be distinguished. Thomas Christiano illustrates the point with a couple of clever comparisons, the first between the state and the baseball umpire, and the second between the state and the movie director. “If a player does nothing to prevent the umpire from watching the pitches and shouting ‘ball’ or ‘strike,’ but refuses to leave the batter’s box after having been called out, he interferes with the umpires calling of the game.” Similarly if an actor on the set of a movie does not actively try to sabotage the production of the film but refuses to follow the director’s instructions, he interferes with the production of the film nevertheless. In the same way, Christiano argues, a citizen that does not attack police or make bomb threats to parliament house in order to obstruct the making of law, but that refuses to obey the law is still guilty of interfering with the state’s legal organization of society. Disobedience is interference. (Christiano, 2004)

William Edmundson avoids this difficulty by specifying that the correlate of legitimate authority is non-interference with the administration and enforcement of laws, rather than non-interference with the state’s regulation of society more broadly. Similarly Patrick Durning argues that legitimate authority corresponds to a duty not to interfere with the state’s attempts to regulate society, which amounts to a duty not to interfere with the issuing of commands and their enforcement. (Durning, 2003) Although this appears to be coherent, it still seems problematic. If we do not have a moral obligation to surrender a percentage of our earnings in tax, for example, how can we be duty-bound to stand idly by and not resist when the taxman comes to seize our money? Alternative accounts such as those put forward by Edmundson and Durning have the odd implication that one can be duty-bound not to resist the enforcement of directives that one has absolutely no moral obligation to comply with. For this reason, the traditional view, according to which legitimate authority and political obligation are correlates, remains the prevailing view.

7. The Weight of Political Obligation

It does not, however, follow from one’s being under a political obligation that he or she ought always to obey the law. Political obligation is prima facie and countervailing moral considerations always need to be taken into account when assessing the right course of action. The weight that should be ascribed to political obligation in any such judgment is, furthermore, an open question.

M.B.E Smith argues that it is negligible. A prima facie duty has considerable weight if and only if; 1) “an act which violates that obligation and fulfils no other is seriously wrong;” and 2) “violation of it will make considerably worse an act which on other grounds is already wrong” (Smith, 1973: 970). Running a stop sign when it is perfectly safe to do so and when there is nobody else around to witness and be influenced by the indiscretion, constitutes a transgression of a citizen’s political obligation. Yet it seems to be a rather trivial wrong for which censure and moral condemnation are not appropriate responses. Political obligation thus flunks the first test. As for the second test, Smith argues that the moral wrongness of an act is not at all amplified by its illegality. Rape and murder are already seriously wrong. They are not made more wrong by the fact that these actions are against the law. From this Smith concludes that political obligation is “at most of trifling weight” (Smith, 1973: 971). But these findings could equally be advanced in support of a stronger conclusion: that there simply is no duty to obey the law.

8. Philosophical Anarchism

There is today a growing consensus to the effect that no theory of political obligation succeeds. But not everybody infers from this that political obligation does not exist. After all, the source and nature of moral requirements more generally may not be adequately captured by any of our theories, but few advance this as proof that we are not bound by moral requirements. We have simply been unable to explain why we are so bound: the theorist has failed to develop a satisfactory account of what is there (or at least might be there). But there are also those for whom the theories surveyed above are exhaustive. All possible grounds of political obligation are covered by these theories, such that if political obligation cannot be derived from either consent, or fairness, or gratitude, then there is no such thing as political obligation (Simmons 1979: 192).

“Philosophical anarchism” is the term used to describe this latter position – that there is no prima facie duty to obey the law, even in a just state, (the flip- side of this being that no state is “legitimate” in the sense of enjoying a right to obedience). Two kinds of philosophical anarchism can be distinguished: A posteriori and a priori.

According to a posteriori philosophical anarchism, no existing state is legitimate or has a right to obedience, but political obligation might be owed to an authority if it satisfied certain conditions. In other words, existing states are illegitimate because of their contingent characters (Simmons 2001: 106). A proponent of this view might, for example, say that residence would generate political obligation if internal succession were allowed and if there were a widely known convention equating residence with consent, but that in so far these conditions do not obtain in any existing state, no existing state is owed obedience (Beran, 1987: 126).

A priori philosophical anarchism, by contrast, denies not only the existence, but also the possibility of a legitimate state. There cannot be a duty to obey the law on this view (Edmundson, 2004: 219, Simmons 2001: 105). Robert Paul Wolff endorses this position. Wolff argues that obedience – acting as the law requires just because the law requires it – is incompatible with the overriding duty of each individual to act in accordance with his or her own moral judgment. Differently put, obedience constitutes an abdication of moral autonomy, which is immoral. This precludes citizens from acquiring political obligation no matter what they say or do. We are necessarily free from political obligation and, accordingly, the notion of a legitimate state “must be consigned [to] the category of the round square, the married bachelor, and the unsensed sense-datum” (Wolff 1970: 71). None of this has anything to do with the contingent character of one’s government (Hopton 1998: 601).

If political obligation does not exist, what follows? Locke declares that an individual “under the exercise of a power without right” – the power of an authority without a claim to his obedience – is “at liberty to appeal to heaven” or to resort to violent resistance (Locke, 1690: II: 168). On this view, philosophical anarchism offers something of a justification for political anarchism – disobedience and resistance to the state. But one can have strong moral reasons for complying with directives issued by his government without owing any obligations to that government. A state might deserve obedience without being entitled to it. Moreover the acts and forbearances required by law are in many cases morally required independently of the law. The fact that a citizen is free from political obligation means only that the law’s demanding something of him is not in itself a morally relevant consideration for behaving accordingly. But the citizen’s pre-existing moral duties will in many (or even most) cases be sufficient to prohibit his acting contrary to the law. Thus, the absence of political obligation does not challenge our understanding of when morality demands conformity with law and non-resistance as dramatically as one might expect.

9. References and Further Reading

General:

  • Allen, R.E., Socrates and Legal Obligation, (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1980).
  • Edmundson, W.A., “State of the Art: The Duty to Obey the Law,” Legal Theory, vol. 10, (2004): 215-259.
  • Edmundson, W.A. (ed.), The Duty to Obey the Law, (Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 1999).
  • Green, L., “Legal Obligation and Authority,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, 2003.
  • Hopton, T., “Political Obligation,” in Encyclopedia of Applied Ethics, vol. 3, (San Diego: academic Press, 1998).
  • Klosko, G., Political Obligations, (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005).
  • McPherson, T., Political Obligation, (London: Routledge, 1967).
  • Pateman, C., The Problem of Political Obligation: A Critique of Liberal Theory, (Cambridge: Polity Press, 1979).
  • Rousseau, J.J., The Social Contract and Discourses by Jean-Jacques Rousseau (1762), trans. G.D.H Cole, (London and Toronto: J.M. Dent and Sons, 1913).
  • Simmons, A.J., “Civil Disobedience and the Duty to Obey the Law,” in R.G. Frey and C.H. Wellman (eds.), A Companion to Applied Ethics (Blackwell Publishing, 2003).
  • Simmons, A.J., Moral Principles and Political Obligations, (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1979).
  • Woozley, A.D., Law and Obedience: The Arguments of Plato’s Crito, (London: Duckworth, 1979).

Fairness:

  • Hart, H.L.A, “Are There Any Natural Rights?” Philosophical Review 64, (April 1955).
  • Klosko, G., “Presumptive Benefit, Fairness, and Political Obligation,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, vol. 16, no. 3, (Summer 1987): 241-259.
  • Klosko, G., The Principle of Fairness and Political Obligation, (Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 1992).
  • Nozick, R., Anarchy, State, and Utopia, (New York: Basic Books, 1974).
  • Rawls, J., A Theory of Justice, (Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1971).
  • Simmons, A.J., “The Principle of Fair Play,” and “Fair Play and Political Obligation: Twenty Years Later,” both in his Justification and Legitimacy: Essays on Rights and Obligations, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).

Gratitude:

  • Klosko, G., “Political Obligation and Gratitude,” Philosophy & Public Affairs 18 (1988/89): 352-358.
  • Walker, A.D., “Obligations of Gratitude and Political Obligation,” Philosophy & Public Affairs 18, (1988/89): 359-364.
  • Walker, A.D., “Political Obligation and the Argument from Gratitude,” Philosophy & Public Affairs 17, (1987/88): 191-211.

Consent:

  • Beran, H., The Consent Theory of Political Obligation, (New York: Croom Helm, 1987).
  • Hume, D., “On the Social Contract,” in A. MacIntyre (ed.), Hume’s Ethical Writings, (New York: Collier-Macmillan, 1965).
  • Jenkins, J.J., “Political Consent,” Philosophical Quarterly, vol. 20 (1970): 60-66.
  • Locke, J., The Second Treatise of Civil Government, (1690) (any edition).
  • Plamenatz, J.P., Consent, Freedom and Political Obligation, 2nd ed., (London, Oxford, New York: Oxford University Press, 1968).
  • Plamenatz, J.P., Man and Society, vol. 1, (London: Longman, 1963).
  • Singer, P., Democracy and Disobedience, (New York and London: Oxford University Press, 1973).
  • Walzer, M., Obligations: Essays on Disobedience, War and Citizenship, (New York: Simon and Schuster, 1970).

Natural Duty:

  • Bentham, J., “A Fragment of Government,” in J. Bowring (ed.), The Works of Jeremy Bentham, (London: Simpkin, Marshall and Co., 1843).
  • Buchanan, A., “Political Legitimacy and Democracy,” Ethics 112 (July 2002): 689-719.
  • Hare, R.M., “Political Obligation,” in Essays on Political Morality, (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1989).
  • Klosko, G., “Political Obligation and the Natural Duties of Justice,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, vol. 23, no. 3, (Summer 1994): 251-70.
  • Wellman, C.H., and A. John Simmons, Is there a Duty to Obey the Law?, (New York: Cambridge University Press, 2005).

Associative theories:

  • Dworkin, R., Law’s Empire, (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, Belknap, 1986).
  • Horton, J. Political Obligation, (Houndmills, Basingstoke, Hampshire: Macmillan, 1992).
  • Simmons, A.J., “Associative Political Obligations,” in his Justification and Legitimacy: Essays on Rights and Obligations, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).

Mixed accounts:

  • Wellman, C.H., “Toward a Liberal Theory of Political Obligation,” Ethics, vol. 111, no. 4, (July 2001): 735-759.
  • Klosko, G., “Multiple Principles of Political Obligation,” Political Theory 32, 6, (2004): 801-824.
  • Lefkowitz, D.A., “Legitimate Authority and the Duty of Those Subject to It: A Critique of Edmundson,” Law and Philosophy 23, (2004): 399-435.
  • Miller, D., On Nationality, (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995).

Relationship to legitimate authority:

  • Christiano, T., “Justice and Disagreement at the Foundations of Political Authority,” Ethics, 110 (October 1999): 165-187.
  • During, P., “Political Legitimacy and the Duty to Obey the Law,” Canadian Journal of Philosophy, vol. 33, no. 3, (September 2003): 373-390.
  • Edmundson, W.A., “Legitimate Authority without Political Obligation,” Law and Philosophy, 17, (1998): 43-60.
  • Greenawalt, K., “Legitimate Authority and the Duty to Obey” in William A. Edmundson (ed.), The Duty to Obey the Law, (Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 1999).

The weight of political obligation, and philosophical anarchism:

  • Dagger, R., “Philosophical Anarchism and its Fallacies: A Review Essay,” Law and Philosophy 19, (2000): 391-406.
  • Edmundson, W.A., Three Anarchical Fallacies: An Essay on Political Authority, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998).
  • Simmons, A.J., “Philosophical Anarchism” in his Justification and Legitimacy: Essays on Rights and Obligations, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).
  • Smith, M.B.E., “Is there a Prima Facie Obligation to Obey the Law?” Yale Law Journal, vol. 82, (April 1973): 950-976
  • Wolff, R.P., In Defense of Anarchism, (New York, Evanston and London: Harper and Row, 1970).

Author Information

Ned Dobos
Email: dobosn@unimelb.edu.au
University of Melbourne
Australia

Self-Consciousness

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has mostly focused on the identification and articulation of specific epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, peculiarities which distinguish it from consciousness of things other than oneself. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, this article discusses the nature of those epistemic and semantic peculiarities.

The relevant epistemic peculiarities are mainly those associated with the alleged infallibility and self-intimation of self-consciousness. It has sometimes been thought that our consciousness of ourselves may be, under certain conditions, infallible, in the sense that it cannot go wrong: when we believe that some fact about us obtains, it does. It has also sometimes been thought that some forms of consciousness are self-intimating: if a certain fact about us obtains, we are necessarily going to be conscious that it does. These claims have come under heavy attack in more recent philosophical work, but it remains unclear whether some restricted forms of infallibility and self-intimation survive the attack.

The relevant semantic peculiarities have emerged in recent work in philosophy of language and mind. Two of them stand out: the so-called immunity to error through misidentification of our consciousness of ourselves and the special character of self-regarding (or de se) consciousness that cannot be assimilated to other kinds of consciousness. Some philosophers have argued that these are not genuine features of self-consciousness, while others have argued that, although genuine, they are not peculiar to self-consciousness. Other philosophers have defended the proposition that these features are genuine and peculiar to self-consciousness. We will consider the case for these claims in due course.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions
  3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?
  4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
  5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
    1. Immunities to Error through Misidentification
    2. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts
  6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?
  7. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Throughout our waking life, we are conscious of a variety of things. We are often conscious of other people, of cars, trees, beetles, and other objects around us. We are conscious of their features: their colors, their shapes, and the sound they make. We are conscious of events involving them: car accidents, tree blooming, and so forth.

Sometimes we are also conscious of ourselves, our features, and the events that take place within us. Thus, we may become conscious, in a certain situation, of the fact that we are nervous or uncomfortable. We may become conscious of a rising anxiety, or of a sudden cheerfulness. Sometimes we are conscious of simpler things: that we are seeing red, or that we are thinking of tomorrow’s errands.

In addition, we sometimes have the sense that we are continuously conscious of ourselves going about our business in the world. Thus William James, who was very influential in the early days of experimental, systematic psychology (in addition to being the brother of novelist Henry James and a gifted writer himself), remarked once that “whatever I may be thinking of, I am always at the same time more or less aware of myself, of my personal existence” (James 1961: 42).

These forms of self-consciousness—consciousness of ourselves and our personal existence, of our character traits and standing features, and of the thoughts that occur to us and the feelings that we experience—are philosophically fascinating, inasmuch as they are at once quite mysterious and closest to home. Our scientific theories of astrophysical objects that are incredibly distant from us in both space and time, or of the smallest particles that make up the sub-atomic layer of reality, are mature, sophisticated, and impressive. By contrast, we barely have anything worth the name “scientific theory” for self-consciousness and its various manifestations, in spite of self-consciousness’ being so much more familiar a phenomenon—indeed the most familiar phenomenon of all.

Here, as elsewhere, the immaturity of our scientific understanding of self-consciousness invites philosophical reflection on the topic, and is anyway partly due precisely to deep philosophical puzzles about the nature of self-consciousness. Many philosophers have thought that self-consciousness exhibits certain peculiarities not to be found in consciousness of things other than ourselves, and indeed possibly not to be found anywhere else in nature.

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has thus mostly focused on the identification and articulation of these peculiarities. More specifically, it has sought some epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, that is, peculiarities as regards how we know, and more generally how we represent, ourselves and our internal lives. (In philosophical jargon, “epistemology” is the theory of knowledge and “semantics” is—more or less—the theory of representation.) This entry will accordingly focus on these peculiarities. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, we will discuss first the nature of the relevant epistemic peculiarities and then (more extensively) the semantic ones.

2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions

Let us start by drawing some distinctions. (The distinctions I will draw are meant as conceptual distinctions. Whether they stand for real differences between the properties putatively picked out by the relevant concepts is a separate matter.) The first important distinction is between self-consciousness as a property of whole individuals and self-consciousness as a property of particular mental states. Thus, when we say “My thought that p is self-conscious” and “I am self-conscious,” the property we ascribe is in all likelihood different. My being self-conscious involves my being conscious of my self. But my thought’s being self-conscious does not involve my thought’s being conscious of its self, since (i) it does not have a self, and (ii) thoughts are not the kind of thing that can be conscious of anything. We may call the property that I have creature self-consciousness and the property that my thought has state self-consciousness.

Another distinction is between consciousness of oneself (one’s self) and consciousness of a particular event or state that occurs within oneself. Compare “I am self-conscious of myself thinking that p” to “I am self-conscious of my thought that p.” The latter involves awareness of a particular thought of mine, but need not involve awareness of self or selfhood. It is a form of self-consciousness in the sense that it is directed inward, and takes as its object an internal state of mine. But it is not a form of self-consciousness in the stronger sense of involving consciousness of self. I will refer to the stronger variety as strong self-consciousness and the weaker as weak self-consciousness. State self-consciousness is consciousness of what happens within oneself, whereas creature self-consciousness is consciousness of oneself proper. (Note, however, that a mental state may be both creature- and state-self-conscious. Thus, if I am conscious of my thought that p as my thought, as a thought of mine, then I am conscious both of my thought and of myself.)

Another traditional distinction, which dates back to Kant, is between consciousness of oneself qua object and consciousness of oneself qua subject. Suppose I am conscious of Budapest (or of Budapest and its odors). I am the subject of the thought, its object is Budapest. But suppose now that I am conscious of myself (or of myself and my feelings). Now I am both the subject and the object of the thought. But although the subject and the object of the thought happen to be the same thing, there is still a conceptual distinction to be made between myself in my capacity as object of thought and myself in my capacity as subject of thought. That is to say, even though there is one entity here, there are two separate concepts for this entity, the self-as-subject concept and the self-as-object concept. To mark this difference, William James (1890) introduced a technical distinction between the I and the me. In its technical use, “I” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-subject, whereas “me” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-object. By “Mentalese correlate,” I mean the expression that would mean the same as “I” and “me” in something like the so-called language of thought (Fodor 1975) or Mentalese.)

Corresponding to these two concepts, or conceptions, of self, there would presumably be two distinct modes of presentation under which a person may be conscious of herself. She may be conscious of herself under the “I” description or under the “me” description. Thus, my state of self-consciousness may employ either the “I” mode of presentation or the “me” mode of presentation. (We could capture the difference, using James’ technical terminology, by distinguishing “I am self-conscious that I think that p” and “I am self-conscious that methinks that p.”) In the latter case, there is a sort of “conceptual distance” between the thing that does the thinking and the thing being thought about. Although I am thinking of myself, I am not thinking of myself as the thing that does the thinking. By contrast, in the former case, I am thinking of myself precisely as the thing that is therewith doing the thinking.

Through Kant’s influence on Husserl, philosophers in the phenomenological tradition have long held that something like consciousness of self-as-subject is a distinct, irreducible, and central aspect of our mental life. Philosophers in the analytic tradition have been more suspicious of it (for exceptions to this rule, see for instance Van Gulick 1988 and Strawson 1997). But the distinction between consciousness of self-as-subject and consciousness of self-as-object might be captured using analytic tools, through a distinction between transitive and intransitive self-consciousness (Kriegel 2003, 2004a). Compare “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” and “I am self-consciously thinking that p.” In the former, transitive form, self-consciousness is construed as a relation between me and my thinking. In the latter, intransitive form, it is construed as a modification of my thinking. That is, in the latter the self-consciousness term (if you will) does not denote a state of standing in a relation to my thought (or my thinking) that p. Rather, it designates the way I am having my thought (or doing my thinking). In transitive self-consciousness, the thought and the state of self-consciousness are treated as two numerically distinct mental states. By contrast, in intransitive self-consciousness, there is no numerical distinction between the thought and the state of self-consciousness: the thought is the state of self-consciousness. The adverb “self-consciously” denotes a way I am having my thought that p. No extra act of self-consciousness takes place after the thought that p occurs. Rather, self-consciously is how the thought that p occurs.

I have been speaking of the self-as-subject in terms of “the thing that does the thinking,” and correspondingly of consciousness of oneself as subject in terms of consciousness of oneself as the thing that does the thinking. But recent work in philosophical psychopathology counsels caution here. Schizophrenics suffering from “thought insertion” and “alien voices” delusions report that they are not in control of their thoughts. Indeed, they often envisage a particular individual who, they claim, is doing the thinking for them, or implants thoughts in their mind. Note that although they do not experience themselves as doing the thinking, they do experience the thinking as happening, in some sense, in them. To account for the experiential difference between doing the thinking and merely hosting the thinking, between authorship of one’s thoughts and mere ownership of them (respectively), some philosophers have drawn a distinction between consciousness of oneself as agent and consciousness of oneself as subject (Campbell 1999, Graham and Stephens 2000). The distinction between self-as-agent and self-as-subject is orthogonal, however, to the distinction between self-as-object and self-as-subject. To avoid confusion, let us suggest a different terminology, that of self-as-author versus self-as-owner, and correspondingly, of consciousness of oneself as author of one’s thoughts and consciousness of oneself as owner of one’s thoughts. To be sure, in the normal go of things, ownership and authorship are inseparable. But the pathological cases show that there is daylight between the two notions.

Another important distinction is between propositional self-consciousness and non-propositional self-consciousness. There is no doubt that there is such a thing as propositional self-consciousness: consciousness that some self-related proposition obtains. Presumably, such self-consciousness has conceptual content. But a strong case can be made that there is a form of self-consciousness that is sub-propositional, as it were, and has non-conceptual content (Bermúdez 1998). When a report of self-consciousness uses a “that” clause, as we just did, it necessarily denotes propositional self-consciousness. But when it does not, as is the case, for instance, with “I am self-conscious of thinking that p,” it is left open whether it is propositional or non-propositional self-consciousness that is denoted. That is, “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” is compatible with, but does not entail, “I am self-conscious that I am thinking that p.” In any case, the terminology leaves it open whether there is a non-propositional or non-conceptual form of self-consciousness.

Other distinctions can certainly be drawn. I have restricted myself to those that will play a role in the discussion to follow. They are five:

(a) State self-consciousness versus creature self-consciousness
(b) Strong versus weak self-consciousness
(c) Transitive versus intransitive self-consciousness
(d) Consciousness of self-as-object versus consciousness of self-as-subject
(e) Consciousness of self-as-author versus consciousness of self-as-owner

As I warned at the opening, these distinctions are meant as conceptual ones. This is doubly significant. First, the fact that there is a distinction between two concepts does not entail that there is a difference between the putative properties picked out by these concepts. Second, the existence of a concept does not entail the existence of the property putatively picked out by that concept. In fact, philosophers have questioned the very existence of self-consciousness.

3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?

Perhaps the best known philosophical threat to the very possibility of self-consciousness hails from Hume’s remarks in the Treatise of Human Nature (I, IV, vi): “For my part, when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other… I never can catch myself without a perception, and never can observe anything but the perception.”

This passage makes two separate claims, of different degrees of skepticism. The modest claim is:

(MC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” oneself without a particular mental state.

MC rules out the possibility of a mental state whose sole object is the self. But though it disallows catching oneself without a perception, it does not disallow catching oneself with a perception. Hume makes the latter, stronger, immodest claim next, however:

(IC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” anything but particular mental states.

IC rules out the possibility of any consciousness of one’s self. That is, it rules out the possibility of creature self-consciousness, allowing only for state self-consciousness.

In assessing Hume’s claims, particularly the immodest one, we must ask, first, what did Hume expect to catch? And second, what sort of catching did he have in mind?

One way to deny the possibility of consciousness of oneself is to reject the existence of a self of which one might be conscious. But the inexistence of a self is not a sufficient condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness: there could still be thoroughly and systematically illusory experience of selfhood that gives rise to a form of (illusory) self-consciousness. Nor is such rejection a necessary condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness. Hume himself not only countenanced the self, he offered a theory of it, namely, the bundle theory. What Hume rejected was the existence of a substantival self, a self that is more than just a stream of consciousness and a sum of experiences. What he rejected is the reifying conception of the self according to which the self is an object among others in the world, a substrate that supports the internal goings-on unfolding therein but is distinct from, and somehow stands above, these proceedings. This rejection is shared today by several philosophers (see, for example, Dennett 1991).

This suggests an answer to our first question, concerning what Hume had expected to catch upon turning into himself. What he expected to catch is a self-substance (if you please). It is unclear, however, why Hume thought that consciousness of oneself, even non-illusory consciousness of oneself, required the existence of a substantival self. Consider how self-consciousness might play out within the framework of Hume’s own bundle theory. Upon turning into herself, a person might become conscious of a particular mental state, say an inexplicable cheerfulness, but become conscious of it as belonging to a larger bundle of mental states, perhaps a bundle that has a certain internal cohesion to it at and across time. In that case, we would be well justified to conceive of this person as conscious of her self.

As for the second question, concerning what sort of “catching” Hume had in mind, it appears that Hume envisioned a quasi-perceptual form of catching. He expected self-consciousness to involve some sort of direct encounter with the self. There is no question that one can believe (or otherwise think purely intellectually) that one is inexplicably cheerful. One can surely entertain purely intellectually the proposition “I am inexplicably cheerful.” But Hume wanted more than that. He wanted to be confronted with his self, by turning inward his mind’s eye, as he would with a chair upon directing his outward gaze in the right direction.

In other words, Hume was working with an introspective model of self-consciousness, according to which self-consciousness involves the employment of an inner sense: an internal mechanism whose operation is analogous in essential respects to the operation of the external senses. This inner sense conception was clearly articulated in Locke: “The other fountain [of] ideas, is the perception of the operations of our own minds within us… And though it be not sense, as having nothing to do with external objects; yet it is very like it, and might properly enough be called internal sense” (Essay Concerning Human Understanding II, i, 4).

The plausibility of the introspective model is very much in contention. Thus, Rosenthal (1986) claims that for self-consciousness to be genuinely analogous with perceptual consciousness, the former would have to exhibit the sort of qualitative character the latter does; but since it does not, it is essentially non-perceptual. On this basis, Rosenthal (2004) proceeds to develop an account of self-consciousness in terms of purely intellectual thoughts about oneself (more specifically, thoughts that are entertained in the presence of their object or referent).

On the other hand, self-consciousness can sometimes have a quality of immediacy about it (and its way of putting us in contact with its objects) that seems to parallel perceptual consciousness. At the same time, philosophers have sometimes charged that self-consciousness is in fact too immediate, indeed unmediated, to be thought of as quasi-perceptual. Thus, Shoemaker (1996) argues that the quasi-perceptual model falters in construing self-consciousness along the lines of the act-object analysis that befits perceptual consciousness. When one is perceptually conscious of a butterfly’s meandering, a distinction is always called for between the act of perceptual consciousness and the meandering butterfly it takes as an object. But when one is conscious of one’s cheerfulness, a parallel distinction between the act of self-consciousness and one’s cheerfulness, supposedly thereby taken as object, is misleading, according to Shoemaker.

One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim here is that while Hume’s argument may be effective against transitive self-consciousness, it is not against intransitive self-consciousness. Recall that transitive self-consciousness requires a duality of mental states, the state of self-consciousness and the state of (for example) cheerfulness. But in intransitive self-consciousness there is no such duality: there is not a distinction between an act of self-consciousness and a separate object taken by it. On this interpretation, Shoemaker’s claim is that being self-conscious of being cheerful may well be impossible, but it is nonetheless possible to be self-consciously cheerful. We might combine Rosenthal’s and Shoemaker’s perspectives and suggest the view that self-consciousness can come in two varieties: intellectual transitive self-consciousness and intransitive self-consciousness. Both varieties escape the clutches of Hume’s threat: one can catch oneself (with a particular mental state) if the catching is intellectual rather than quasi-perceptual, or if the catching is somehow fused into the particular mental state thereby caught. What Hume showed is that quasi-perceptual transitive self-consciousness is impossible; but this leaves untouched the possibility of intellectual transitive self-consciousness and of intransitive self-consciousness.

In summary, it is quite likely that self-consciousness is indeed possible. But reflecting on the conditions of its possibility puts non-trivial constraints on our conception of self-consciousness. In this respect, contending with Hume’s challenge still proves immensely fruitful. If anything, it wakes us from our dogmatic slumber about self-consciousness and brings up the question of the nature of self-consciousness.

One question regarding the nature of self-consciousness that arises immediately is what is to count as having self-consciousness. Many contemporary cognitive scientists have operationalized the notion of self-consciousness in terms of experiments on mirror self-recognition and the so-called “mark test.” In these experiments, a creature’s forehead is marked with a visible stain. When placed in front of a mirror, some creatures try to wipe off the stain, which suggests that they recognize themselves in the mirror, while others do not (see mainly Gallup 1970, 1977). Successes with the mark test are few and far between. Among primates, it is passed with any consistency only by humans, chimpanzees, and orangutans, but not by gorillas or gibbons (Suarez and Gallup 1981); and even humans do not typically pass it before the age of a year and a half (Amsterdam 1972) and chimpanzees not before three years of age nor after sixteen years of age (Povinelli et al. 1993). Outside the group of primates, it is passed only by bottlenose dolphins (Reiss and Marino 2001) and Asian elephants (Plotnik et al. 2006). However, this operational treatment of self-consciousness is problematic at a number of levels. Most importantly, it is not entirely clear what the true relationship between mirror self-recognition and self-consciousness is. One would need a principled account of the latter in order to clarify that matter. Mirror self-recognition experiments thus cannot take precedence over the search for an independent understanding of self-consciousness.

To that end, let us consider the ways in which self-consciousness has been claimed to be different, special, and sometimes privileged, relative to consciousness of things other than oneself. Early modern philosophers, from Descartes on, have often claimed certain epistemic privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. More recently, twentieth century analytic philosophers have attempted to identify certain semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness. We take those up in turns.

4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

In what follows, we will consider, somewhat hastily, about a dozen epistemic peculiarities sometimes attributed to self-consciousness. Traditionally, the most discussed special feature claimed on behalf of self-consciousness is infallibility. According to the doctrine of infallibility, one’s consciousness of oneself is always veridical and accurate. We may say that whenever I am self-conscious of thinking that p, I am indeed thinking that p. It is important to note, however, that to the extent that “self-conscious of” is a success verb, this claim would be trivially true, whereas the point of the doctrine under consideration is that it is true even if “self-conscious of” is not a success verb (or also for any non-success uses of the verb). To bypass this technicality, let us insert parenthetically the qualifier “seemingly” into our formulation of the claim. We may formulate the doctrine of infallibility as follows:

(DIF) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I believe something about myself and my mental life, the belief is true: things are in fact the way I believe them to be.

The doctrine of infallibility ensures that my beliefs about my mental life are true. A parallel doctrine ensures that such beliefs are (epistemically) justified. We may, without too much injustice to traditional terminology, call this the doctrine of incorrigibility. The traditional notion of incorrigibility is the notion that the subject cannot possibly be corrected by anyone else, which suggests that the subject is in possession of (and makes correct use of) all the relevant evidence. We may thus formulate the doctrine of incorrigibility as follows:

(DIC) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am justifiably (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p.

Whereas according to DIF, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is true, according to DIC, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is justified.

Against the background of the tripartite analysis of knowledge, the conjunction of DIC and DIF would entail a doctrine about self-knowledge in general, namely:

(DIK) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious that I am thinking that p, then I know that I am thinking that p.

That is, if I am in a state of self-consciousness whose content is “I am thinking that p”, then my state of self-consciousness will necessarily qualify as knowledge. Note, however, that the thesis is entailed by DIF and DIC only against the background of the tripartite analysis—though it may be independently true. (If the tripartite analysis is incorrect, as it probably is, then the thesis does not follow from the conjunction of DIC and DIF. But it can still be formulated.)

The three doctrines we have considered claim strong privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. But there are stronger ones. Consider the converse of the doctrine of infallibility. DIF ensures that when I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am in fact thinking that p. Its converse is a stronger thesis: whenever I think that p, I am self-conscious of doing so. That is, nothing can pass through the mind without the mind taking notice of it. Having a thought entails being self-conscious of having it. Thoughts are, in this sense, self-intimating. We may formulate the doctrine of self-intimation as follows:

(DSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I think something, I inevitably come to believe (or be aware) that I am. Note that DSI entails DIF, because if I am indeed thinking that p, then my self-consciousness of thinking that p must be true or veridical.

A distinction is sometimes made between weak self-intimation and strong self-intimation (Shoemaker 1996). What we have just considered is the weak variety. The strong variety ensures not only that when I think something, I am aware that I think it, but also that when I do not think something, I am aware that I do not think it. Let us formulate the doctrine of strong self-intimation as follows:

(DSSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I am not thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Strong self-intimation renders the mind in some traditional sense transparent to itself. But the term “transparency” has had such wide currency in recent philosophy of mind that it would be better not to use it in the present context.

Consider now the converse of the doctrine of incorrigibility. It is the thesis that if I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p. It also entails DIF, as well as DSI. Again, a strong version can be formulated: If I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I do not think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Finally, a parallel thesis could be formulated regarding knowledge: If I think that p, then I know that I think that p. The strong version would be:

(OSC) If I think that p, then I know that I think that p, and if I do not think that p, then I know that I do not think that p.

This last feature is probably the strongest epistemic privilege that could be claimed on behalf of self-consciousness. We may call the associated doctrine the Omniscience of Self-Consciousness. For it is the thesis that one knows everything that happens within one’s mind, and everything that does not.

Freud’s work on the unconscious has all but refuted the above doctrines (see especially Freud 1915). Thus few if any philosophers would defend them today. But many may consider restricted versions of them. The above doctrines are formulated in terms of thoughts, understood as mental states in general. But some theses can be formulated that would restrict the epistemic privileges to a special subset of mental states, such as sensations and feelings, or phenomenally conscious states, or some such. A thus restricted self-intimation thesis might read: if I have a sensation S, then I am self-conscious of having S; or, if I have a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am self-conscious of having S.

Counter-examples to even such appropriately restricted theses have been offered in the literature. Staying with self-intimation, it has been suggested that there are sensations and conscious states that occur without their subject’s awareness. Arguably, I may have a sensation—indeed, a phenomenally conscious sensation—of the refrigerator’s hum without becoming self-conscious of it, let alone of myself hearing it.

Consider now a restricted version of the infallibility doctrine: If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having sensation S, then I do have sensation S. An alleged counter-example is the fraternity initiation story. Suppose that, blindfolded, I am told that a particular spot on my neck is about to be cut with a razor (this is part of my fraternity initiation); then an ice cube is placed on that spot. At the very first instant, I am likely to be under the impression that I am having a pain sensation, while in reality I am having a coldness sensation. That is, at that instant, I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having a pain sensation but do not in fact have a pain sensation, or so the argument goes (see Horgan and Kriegel 2007).

Another way to restrict the above doctrines is by making their claims weaker. Consider the following variation on self-intimation: If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking. Whereas DSI claims that when I have the thought that p, I am self-conscious not just of having a thought, but of having specifically the thought that p, this variation claims only that I am self-conscious of having a thought—some thought.

We can apply strictures of this type to any of the above doctrines, and some of the resulting theses may be quite plausible. Thus, consider the following thesis:

If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of being in a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am in some phenomenally conscious state.

It is difficult to conceive of a situation in which one is aware of oneself as being in some conscious state when in fact one is in no conscious state (and hence is unconscious). In particular, the fraternity initiation tale does not tell against this thesis: although in the story I am not in fact in a pain state, I am nonetheless in some conscious state.

Such nuanced theses may thus survive modern critiques of the traditional doctrines of epistemic privilege. Their exploration in the literature is, in any case, far from complete. But let us move on to the semantic privileges sometimes imputed on self-consciousness.

5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

a. Immunities to Error through Misidentification

On the two extremes, the first-person pronoun “I” has been claimed by some to be entirely non-referential (Anscombe 1975) and by others to be the only true form of reference (Chisholm 1976 Ch. 3, and in a more nuanced way, Lewis 1979). Presumably, analogous statements could be made about the concept we use in thought in order to think about ourselves in the first person. For convenience, I will call the relevant concept the Mentalese first-person pronoun, or just the Mentalese “I”. Plausibly, the special features of linguistic self-reference (the way “I” refers) derive from, or at least parallel, corresponding features of self-consciousness, and more specifically mental self-reference (the way the Mentalese “I” refers). In the present context, it is the latter that interest us. Our discussion will focus on two main features. In the next section, we will consider the alleged essential indexicality of self-consciousness (Perry 1979) and irreducibility of de se thoughts (Castañeda 1966, 1967, 1968, 1969). (These terms will be explicated in due course.) The present section considers a semantic peculiarity pointed out by Sydney Shoemaker (1968) under the name “immunity to error through misidentification relative to the first-person pronoun” and related peculiarities discussed by Anscombe (1975), Evans (1982), and others.

When I think about things other than myself, there are two ways in which my thoughts may turn out to be false. Suppose I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person. I may be wrong about either (i) whether he is a nice person or (ii) who my next-door neighbor is. The first error is one of mispredication, if you will, whereas the second is one of misidentification. Thus, if I mistake my neighbor’s tendency to smile for kindness, when in fact it serves a cynical ploy to lure me into signing an unjust petition against the superintendent, then I make a mistake of the first kind. By contrast, if I mistake the mailman for my next-door neighbor, and think that it is my next-door neighbor who is a nice person, when in fact it is the mailman who is, then I make a mistake of the second kind.

In this sense, my thought that my next-door neighbor is a nice person displays a composite structure, involving identification and predication. We may represent this by saying that my thought has the internal structure “my next-door neighbor is the person smiling at me every morning & the person smiling at me every morning is a nice person”, or more generally “my next-door neighbor is the φ & the φ is a nice person”. This is not to say that when I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person I am thinking this as a conjunction, or that my thought takes a conjunctive proposition as its object. The above conjunctive representation of my thought is meant just as a device to bring out the fact that my thought has a composite structure. The point is just that my thought has two separable components, an identificational component and a predicational component.

Correspondingly, we can envisage three sorts of semantic peculiarity or privilege. (1) There could be a kind of thought K1, such that if a thought T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to mispredication; thoughts of kind K1 are thus immune to error through misidentification. (2) There could be a kind of thought K2, such that if T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to misidentification; thoughts of kind K2 are thus immune to error through mispredication. (3) There could be a kind of thought K3, such that if T is of that kind, then T can be false due to neither mispredication nor misidentification; thoughts of kind K3 are thus immune to error tout court. The above are just definitions of privileges. It remains to be seen whether any of these definitions is actually satisfied. Shoemaker’s claim is that the first definition is indeed satisfied by a certain subset of thoughts about oneself.

Note that the third peculiarity, immunity to error tout court, is basically infallibility. This way of conceiving of immunity to error through misidentification brings out its relation to the more traditional doctrine of infallibility. Unlike the latter, the doctrine of immunity to error through misidentification does not claim blanket immunity. But it does restrict in a principled manner the ways in which the relevant thoughts may turn out to be false. If I think that I feel angry, then I can be wrong about whether that is a feeling I really have, but I cannot be wrong about whom it is that is allegedly angry.

We said that according to Shoemaker, a certain subset of thoughts about oneself is immune to error through misidentification. What subset? One can think about oneself under any number of descriptions. And some descriptions one may not be aware of as applying to one. Thus, I may think that my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew is brown-eyed, without being aware that I am my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew. In that case, I think about myself, but not as myself. We might say that I have a thought about myself, but not a self-aware thought about myself. Let us call self-aware thoughts about oneself I-thoughts. According to Shoemaker, some I-thoughts are immune to error through misidentification, namely, those I-thoughts that are directed to one’s mind and mental life, as opposed to one’s body and corporeal life. (To take an example from Wittgenstein, suppose I see in the mirror a tangle of arms and I mistakenly take the nicest one to be mine. I may think to myself “I have a nice arm.” In that case, I may not only be wrong about whether my arm is nice, but also about whom it is that has a nice arm. Such an I-thought, being about my body, is not immune to error through misidentification. But my thoughts about my mind are so immune, claims Shoemaker.) More accurately, as we will see later on, Shoemaker holds that absolute, as opposed to circumstantial, immunity to error through misidentification applies only to mental I-thoughts.

We should distinguish two versions of the doctrine of immunity. According to the first, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because the identifications they involve are always and necessarily correct; call this the infallible identification (II) version of the doctrine of immunity. According to the second version, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because they do not involve identification in the first place; call this the identificationless reference (IR) version of the doctrine of immunity. (Brook [2001] speaks of ascriptionless reference, which may also be a good label for the specific feature under consideration.) Both versions claim a certain distinction on behalf of the relevant I-thoughts, but the distinction is very different. The first version claims the distinction of infallible identification, whereas the second one claims the distinction of dispensable identification.

Shoemaker appears to hold the IR version (see, for example, Shoemaker 1968: 558). In some respects this is the more radical version. On the II version, I-thoughts have the same composite structure as other thoughts. When I think that I am amused, the content of my thought has the structure “I am the φ & the φ is amused”. It is just that there is something special about the identificational component in the relevant I-thoughts that makes it impervious to error. Whenever I think that I am the φ, I am. The IR version is more radical. It claims that the relevant I-thoughts do not have the same composite structure as other thoughts—that they are structurally different. More specifically, they lack any identificational component. My thought that I am amused hooks onto me in some direct, identification-free way.

The distinction between these two versions is important, because the burden of argument is very different in each case. To make the case for II, one would have to argue that the relevant self-identifications are infallible. To make the case for IR, by contrast, one would have to argue that the relevant I-thoughts are identification-free. There is also a corresponding difference in explanatory burden. II must explain how is it that certain acts of identification are impervious to error, whereas IR must explain how is it that some acts of reference can dispense with identification altogether (How do they hook onto the right referent without identifying it?).

Shoemaker’s (1968) argument for IR, in its barest outlines, proceeds as follows. Suppose (for reductio) that every self-reference required self-identification. Then every thought with a content “I am F” would have the internal structure “I am the φ & the φ is F”. That is, ascertaining that one is F would require that one identify oneself as the φ and then establish that the φ is F. But this would entail that the same would apply to “I am the φ”: it would have to have the internal structure “I am the ψ & the ψ is the φ”. That is, in order to ascertain that one is the φ, one would have to first identify oneself as the ψ and then establish that the ψ is the φ. And so on ad infinitum. To avert infinite regress, at least some self-reference must be identification-free.

To claim that immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is to claim that it is a feature peculiar to self-consciousness. One can deny this claim in two ways: (i) by arguing that it is not a feature of self-consciousness, and (ii) by arguing that it is not peculiar to self-consciousness (that is, although it is a feature of self-consciousness, it is also a feature of other forms of consciousness).

Several philosophers have pursued (i). Perhaps the most widely discussed argument is the following, due to Gareth Evans (1982: 108). On the basis of seeing in a mirror a large number of hands, one of which is touching a piece of cloth, and a certain feeling I have in my hand, as of touching a piece of cloth, I come to think that I am feeling a piece of cloth. But this is false, and false due to misidentification: I am not the one who is feeling the piece of cloth. Therefore, there are states of self-consciousness that are not immune to error through misidentification; so such immunity is not a feature of self-consciousness as such.

Arguably, however, this is not a pure case of self-consciousness. The thought in question involves self-consciousness, but it is also partly consciousness of something external, and it is the latter part of it that leads to the error. Consider the difference between the thought “I am feeling a piece of cloth” and the thought “I am having a feeling as of a piece of cloth,” or even more perspicuously, “I am having a cloth-ish feeling.” It is clear that if it turns out to be erroneous that I am having a cloth-ish feeling, it is not because I have misidentified myself in the mirror. Indeed, what I see in the mirror is entirely irrelevant to the truth of my thought that I am having a cloth-ish feeling.

More often, philosophers have pursued (ii), arguing that immunity to error through misidentification is not peculiar to self-consciousness. Evans (1982) himself, for instance, argued that thoughts about one’s body, and even certain perceptions and perception-based judgments, can be equally immune to error through misidentification, indeed be identification-free. When I think that my legs are crossed, my thought seems to be immune to error through misidentification: it cannot turn out that someone’s legs are indeed crossed, but not mine.

One response would be to claim that thoughts about one’s own body are a genuine form of self-consciousness, albeit bodily self-consciousness. But another would be to draw finer distinctions between kinds of immunity and attach a specific sort of immunity to self-consciousness. Shoemaker (1968) distinguished between absolute and circumstantial immunity to error through misidentification, claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the absolute variety. In the same vein, McGinn (1983) distinguishes between derivative and non-derivative immunity to error through misidentification, and Pryor (1999) between de re misidentification and which-object misidentification, both claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the latter. However, Stanley (1998) erects a considerable challenge to all these attempts. The issue of whether some kind of immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is still very much debated.

Let us end this section with a few general points. First, immunity to error through misidentification is at bottom a semantic, not an epistemic, peculiarity. It concerns the special way the Mentalese “I” hooks onto its referent. Thus, immunity to error through misidentification is not to be confused with immunity to error through unjustified identification, immunity to unjustifiedness through misidentification, or immunity to unjustifiedness through unjustified identification—all of which would be epistemic peculiarities.

Second, immunity to error through misidentification is a semantic peculiarity of strong self-consciousness, not weak self-consciousness, since it involves essentially consciousness of oneself, not just consciousness of a particular thought of one. So, if I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, it may be that I am not thinking that p, but only because it is not thinking that p that I am doing—not because it is not I who is doing the thinking.

Third, Shoemaker’s “discovery” of immunity preceded the Kripkean revolution in philosophy of language and more generally the theory of reference. A question therefore arises concerning the relation between his claim that self-reference is identification-free and Kripke’s claim that many kinds of reference are direct or rigid. Direct reference—which is commonly thought to characterize proper names, natural kind terms, and indexicals—is reference that is sense-free, if you will: it does not employ a sense, or mode of presentation, in hooking onto the referent. What is the relation, then, between sense-free reference and identification-free reference?

A natural thought is that some (perhaps all) senses are identifications, and so identification-freedom is simply one special case of sense-freedom. If so, Shoemaker’s “discovery” may be just a foreshadowing of the Kripkean revolution: it is the discovery of the possibility of sense-free reference, but with an overly restrictive assessment of its scope (where Kripke claimed that all sorts of representational devices are sense-free, Shoemaker thought that only “I” is).

But there is also another view of the matter. Kripke’s directly referential terms do not employ senses, but they do employ reference-fixers. When I think that Tom is generous, there is something that fixes the reference of my Mentalese concept for Tom—for example, the fact that Tom is the salient person called “Tom.” This reference-fixing fact is not necessarily something I am aware of, which is why it does not qualify as a sense. But it is nonetheless operative in the reference-fixing. When thinking that Tom is generous, I am performing an identification of Tom, albeit an implicit identification, one of which I am not explicitly aware. One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim is that self-reference does not even employ a reference-fixer. It is not only sense-free, but also reference-fixer-free. It is not only that the relevant I-thoughts hook onto oneself without the subject performing an explicit identification, but they hook onto oneself without the subject performing any identification, explicit or implicit. If so, Shoemaker’s claim is more radical than Kripkean direct reference: identification-free reference is not just direct, it is entirely unmediated.

A similar point can be made with respect to Elizabeth Anscombe’s claim that, unlike all other expressions, “I” cannot fail to refer. So I-thoughts are “secure from reference-failure” (Anscombe 1975: 149). That is, such I-thoughts as “I am feeling hungry” are, in effect, immune to error through reference-failure. What is the relation between immunity to error through misidentification and immunity to error through reference-failure? One view would be that there is no difference—the two are the same. But this would make Shoemaker’s ultimate claim that the relevant I-thoughts enjoy identification-freedom the same as Anscombe’s ultimate claim that they enjoy reference-freedom. Shoemaker states explicitly that “I” does refer, though in some identification-free manner. One way to make sense of this is by appeal, again, to freedom from reference-fixing. Here identification-free reference is construed as reference-fixer-free reference. On this view, the Mentalese “I” is referential, but it has the peculiarity that its reference is unmediated by any reference-fixing mechanism.

A crucial issue that remains unaddressed is how reference-fixer-free reference is possible. How can a representational item “find” its referent without any mechanism ensuring a connection between them? Any general theory of self-consciousness that embraces Shoemaker’s IR version of the doctrine of immunity must explain the possibility of reference unfixed. To my knowledge, this challenge remains to be broached in the literature.

b. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts

In the last section we saw that, when one employs the Mentalese “I” in thought, one’s thought probably acquires certain unusual features. In this section, we will see that in certain thoughts one cannot avoid employing the Mentalese “I.” This, too, is a semantic peculiarity, albeit of a different order.

In a well-known story, John Perry tells of his experience following a trail of sugar in a supermarket and thinking to himself “The shopper with the torn bag of sugar is making a mess.” Upon realizing that he is the person with the torn bag, he forms a new thought, “I am making a mess.” This thought is new: its functional role is different from the one of the original thought. Perry’s subsequent actions can be explained by ascribing to him this I-thought in a way they cannot by ascribing to him the “I”-free thought. Perry calls beliefs such as “I am making a mess” locating beliefs, and argues that such beliefs cannot avoid employing Mentalese indexicals. There is no way to think the same thought without employing the Mentalese “I.” Such a thought thus contains an essential indexical, or more accurately, essentially contains an indexical reference. In this sense, these thoughts are irreducible to any other, non-indexical kind of thought.

It should be emphasized that the point here is not that such I-thoughts cannot be reported by anyone other than the subject, or that such first-person reports cannot be matched by third-person reports. In direct speech (oratio recta), one might report Perry’s I-thought as follows:

(1) Perry thinks “I am making a mess”.

The same report could be made more naturally in indirect speech (oratio obliqua). In order to do so, however, one would need to employ what linguists call an indirect reflexive. Some languages apparently contain unique words for the indirect reflexives. English does not. But fortunately, the English indirect reflexives were discerned in the late 1960s by Hector-Neri Castañeda (curiously perhaps, not himself a native speaker). Castañeda showed that (1) is equivalent to:

(2) Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.

At least this is so for paradigmatic uses of “he himself.” (There are also uses of “he” that function in this way, but these are more rare. And there are probably—somewhat unusual—uses of “he himself” that do not function this way. Castañeda introduced the term “he*” as a term that behaves as an indirect reflexive in all its uses.) Castañeda called reports of this sort de se (that is, of oneself) and claimed that de se reports cannot be paraphrased into any de dicto or de re reports, and are thus semantically unique and irreducible. Correlatively, the mental states reported in de se reports, to which we may refer as de se thoughts, are irreducible to mental states reported in de dicto and de re reports. In a “material mode of speech,” this means that states of self-consciousness form an irreducible class of mental states.

Note, in any case, that Castañeda’s thesis is a generalization from Perry’s thesis about reports of one’s own self-conscious states (that is, first-person reports) to all reports of self-conscious states, including reports of others’ self-conscious states (third-person reports). According to Castañeda’s thesis, self-reference is irreducible to either de dicto or de re reference to what is in fact oneself. Castañeda argues for this by showing that the indirect reflexives “he himself,” “she herself,” and so forth, have special logical features. Thus (2) cannot be paraphrased into any (indirect-speech) report that does not employ “he himself.” Consider the following de dicto report:

(3) Perry thinks that the author of “The Essential Indexical” is making a mess.

The truth conditions of (3) and (2) are different, since the latter does not entail the former: Perry may be unaware that it is he who is the author of “The Essential Indexical” (that is, that he himself is the author of “The Essential Indexical”). So (3) and (2) are not equivalent. Presumably, the same goes for any other description “the φ” that picks out Perry uniquely—it could always be that Perry is unaware that he himself is the φ.

Consider next a de dicto report with a proper name instead of a definite description:

(4) Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess.

Again, Perry may be unaware that it is he who is Perry. Therefore, the truth conditions of (2) and (4) are different, and the two are not equivalent. What about the de re versions of (3) and (4)? These can be obtained, in fact, by reading “the author of ‘The Essential Indexical’” and “Perry” in (3) and (4) as used, in Donnellan’s (1966) terms, referentially rather than attributively. But the de re versions are more perspicuously put as follows:

(5) Perry thinks, of the author of “The Essential Indexical,” that he is making a mess.

(6) Perry thinks, of Perry, that he is making a mess.

Boër and Lycan (1980), for instance, claim that (2) is equivalent to (6). But Castañeda argued that it is not. The argument proceeded as follows. The conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists” entails (6), and likewise, the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists” entails (5). But neither the conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists,” nor the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists,” entails (2). Thus, “Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess” and “Perry exists” do not entail “Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.” Therefore, (2) has a different logical force from, and is thus not equivalent to, either (6) or (5). There is perhaps only one approach that may plausibly succeed in reducing de se reports to de dicto ones. It is the approach Eddy Zemach (1985) refers to as neo-Cartesian, and according to which the thought “I am making a mess” is equivalent to:

(7) The thinker of this very thought is making a mess.

On this approach, (2) is equivalent to:

(8) Perry thinks that the thinker of that very thought is making a mess.

In terms of the distinction drawn in §1, the idea here is that self-consciousness is essentially indexical and irreducibly de se inasmuch as it is consciousness of self-as-subject. On this approach, one’s self-conscious thought refers to oneself by referring to itself. In other words, one’s self-reference is mediated by the self-reference of one’s thought.

The emerging view is quite natural. Just as an utterance of the word “I” refers to whoever betokened that very utterance, so a deployment of the Mentalese “I” refers to whoever betokened that very deployment, that is, the thinker of that very I-thought. It may be that “I” is not synonymous with “the utterer of this very word,” but surely the latter functions as the reference-fixer of the former. Likewise, even if the Mentalese “I” is not synonymous with a Mentalese “the thinker of this very thought,” the latter still functions as the reference-fixer of the former.

One problem with the neo-Cartesian approach, however, is that it replaces one sort of indexical self-reference with another. It replaces the thinker’s self-reference with the self-reference of his or her thought. We are thus left with an unexplained essential and irreducible indexical self-reference.

Castañeda actually discussed the neo-Cartesian approach before it was expounded by Zemach, and found a different fault in it. According to Castañeda, what dooms the approach is “the fact, which philosophers (especially Hume and Kant) have known all along, that there is no object of experience that one could perceive as the self that is doing the perceiving” (Castañeda 1966: 64). Whether or not it reflects Hume’s or Kant’s thinking on self-consciousness, the idea is that the subject of thought cannot be thought about as such. Castañeda is effectively denying here the possibility of consciousness of oneself-as-subject. When I think about myself and my mental life, what I am thinking of thereby becomes the object of my thought. I cannot think of myself qua the subject of thought, that is, the thing that does the thinking. The self-as-subject is in this way elusive. As Ryle (1949) put it, trying to think of the self-as-subject is like trying to hop on one’s own shadow: every time you take a step back in order to observe your self-as-subject, your self-as-subject takes a step back with you, as it were.

This objection may apply with more force to what we called in §1 transitive self-consciousness than to what we called intransitive self-consciousness. Even if I cannot become self-conscious of thinking that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful, it does not follow that I cannot self-consciously think that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful. This is because, as pointed out in §1, self-consciously thinking that p, unlike being self-conscious of thinking that p, does not involve two separate states, such that the second one takes the first one as its object. That is, intransitive self-consciousness does not involve “taking a step back,” which is required for Ryle’s regress to get going.

We cannot pursue this issue here with any seriousness. It seems clear, however, that if de se thoughts are not irreducible to de dicto thoughts, it would probably be because the Mentalese “I” can be somehow understood in terms of reference to the subject of the very act of referring. Either way, there is almost certainly some semantic peculiarity to be reckoned with here. The question is merely how best to characterize that peculiarity.

6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?

Discussions of the peculiarities of self-consciousness, both epistemic and semantic, mostly focus on whether a given alleged peculiarity in fact obtains or is merely alleged. But as Brook (2001) stresses, these peculiarities must also be explained, or accounted for, in the context of a general theory of self-consciousness. With a handful of exceptions (for example, Bermúdez 1998) current work on self-consciousness does not appear to address the need for a general theory thereof. Instead, it rests content with a piecemeal treatment of each alleged peculiarity in separation from the rest. Sooner or later, however, this will have to be rectified by a reorientation or reorganization of research in this area.

The alleged peculiarities of self-consciousness will then come in handy. For they are useful in providing explananda for any putative theory of self-consciousness, or data against which to “test” such a theory (this is indeed how Bermúdez 1998 proceeds). This is not to say that they must be the only explananda. Such empirical data as are gleaned from mirror self-recognition experiments and other studies of animal metacognition should also be accommodated by a philosophical theory of self-consciousness.

My suggestion is that a general theory of self-consciousness could be configured in two steps. The first would be to determine which of the alleged epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness in fact obtain. The second would be to devise an account of the metaphysical structure, as well as of the cognitive mechanisms underlying the formation, of states of self-consciousness, such that the relevant account would explain, by predicting or “retrodicting” (as C. S. Peirce puts it), the obtaining of just those peculiarities.

The peculiarities discerned in the second half of the last century are so subtle that we should be open to the idea that there may be further peculiarities which have yet to be “discovered.” There may also be familiar peculiarities that have not been recognized as such. Thus, some recent authors have drawn a new connection between self-consciousness and Moore’s paradox, which presents the challenge of understanding the logical impropriety of beliefs or thoughts of the form “p & I do not believe that p” (see Moran 2001, Kriegel 2004b, and Fernández 2006). Thus it may well be that Moore’s Paradox is at bottom another peculiarity of self-consciousness.

All this suggests that, as far as philosophical research on self-consciousness is concerned, the hardest, but in a way the most interesting, challenges are yet to be faced. At present, the philosophical literature on self-consciousness is quite disparate in the respects mentioned above. But it invites unification under a systematic framework for a general theory of self-consciousness. The most philosophically rewarding work on self-consciousness is still ahead of us.

7. References and Further Reading

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  • Anscombe, G. E. M. 1975. “The First Person.” In S. Guttenplan (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon Press. Reprinted in Cassam 1994.
  • Bayne, T. 2004. “Self-Consciousness and the Unity of Consciousness.” The Monist 87: 219-236.
  • Bealer, G. 1996. “Functionalism and Self-Consciousness.” Philosophical Review 106: 69-117.
  • Bermúdez, J. L. 1998. The Paradox of Self-Consciousness. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
  • Boër, S. and W. G. Lycan. 1980. “Who, Me?” Philosophical Review 89: 427-466.
  • Boër, S. and W. G. Lycan. 1986. Knowing Who. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
  • BonJour, L. 1999. “The Dialectic of Foundationalism and Coherentism.” In J. Greco and E. Sosa (eds.), The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
  • BonJour, L. 2001. “Towards a Defense of Foundationalism.” In M. DePaul (ed.), Resurrecting Old-Fashioned Foundationalism. Lanham, MD: Roiwman and Littlefield.
  • Brook, A. 2001. “Kant, Self-Awareness and Self-Reference.” In Brook and DeVidi 2001.
  • Brook, A. and R. DeVidi (eds.) 2001. Self-Reference and Self-Awareness. Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Co.
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  • Cassam, Q. (ed.) 1994. Self-Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford UP.
  • Cassam, Q. 1997. Self and World. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Castañeda, H.-N. 1966. “‘He’: A Study in the Logic of Self-Consciousness.” Ratio 8: 130-157. Reprinted in Brook and DeVidi 2001.
  • Castañeda, H.-N. 1967. “The Logic of Self-Knowledge.” Noûs 1: 9-21.
  • Castañeda, H.-N. 1968. “On the Logic of Attributions of Self-Knowledge to Others.” Journal of Philosophy 65: 439-456.
  • Castañeda, H.-N. 1969. “On the Phenomno-Logic of the I.” In Proceedings of the 14th International Congress of Philosophy III. Reprinted in Cassam 1994.
  • Castañeda, H.-N. 1987. “Self-Consciousness, Demonstrative Reference, and the Self-Ascription View of Believing.” Philosophical Perspectives 1: 405-454.
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  • Donnellan, K. 1966. “Reference and Definite Descriptions.” Philosophical Review 75: 281-304.
  • Evans, G. 1982. “Self-Identification.” In his The Varieties of Reference (edited by J. McDowell). Oxford: Oxford UP. Reprinted in Brook and DeVidi 2001.
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  • Fernández, J. 2003. “Privileged Access Naturalized.” Philosophical Quarterly 53: 352-372.
  • Fernández, J. 2006. “Self-Knowledge, Rationality, and Moore’s Paradox.” Forthcoming in Philosophy and Phenomenological Research.
  • Fodor, J. A. 1975. The Language of Thought. Cambridge MA: Harvard UP.
  • Freud, S. 1915. “The Unconscious.” In his Metapsychological Essays. Trans. J. Strachey. New York: Collier/Macmillan, 1963.
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  • Gallup, G. G. 1970. “Chimpanzees: Self-Recognition.” Science 167: 86-87.
  • Gallup, G. G. 1977. “Self-Recognition in Primates.” American Psychologist 32:329-338.
  • Garcia-Carpintero, M. 1998. “Indexicals as Token-Reflexives.” Mind 107: 529-563.
  • Geach, P. “On Beliefs about Oneself.” Analysis 18: 23-24.
  • Gertler, B. 2001. “Introspecting Phenomenal States.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 63:305-28.
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Author Information

Uriah Kriegel
Email: theuriah@gmail.com
University of Arizona
U. S. A.

Ethics and Self-Deception

Self-deception has captured the interest of philosophers, psychologists, and other students of human nature. Philosophers of mind and action have worked towards developing an account of self-deception and, in so doing, an explanation of its possibility. They have asked questions concerning the origin and structure of self-deception: How is self-deception possible? Do self-deceivers hold contradictory beliefs? And do they intentionally bring about their self-deception? While these questions have received a great deal of attention from philosophers, they certainly do not exhaust the topic of its conceptual intrigue. Self-deception gives rise to numerous important ethical questions as well—questions concerning the moral status, autonomy, and well-being of the self-deceiver.

Many worries concerning self-deception stem from the self-deceiver’s distorted view of the world and of himself or herself. Some philosophers believe that the self-deceiver’s warped perception of things may enable or encourage him or her to act in immoral ways. Other philosophers, such as Immanuel Kant, fear that the “ill of untruthfulness” involved in cases of self-deception may spread throughout the self-deceiver’s life and interpersonal relationships. These concerns about truth and perception point to further questions regarding the autonomy of the self-deceiver. Can a self-deceiver be fully autonomous while lacking important information about the world? Is the possession of true beliefs a necessary condition for autonomous decisions and action? This article will consider these and other issues concerning the ethics of self-deception.

Table of Contents

  1. What Is Self-Deception?
    1. Conceptual Challenges
    2. Divided Mind Accounts
    3. Deflationary Accounts
    4. Other Approaches
  2. Conscience and Moral Reflection
  3. Truth and Credulity
  4. Autonomous Belief and Action
  5. Responsibility
  6. Conclusions
  7. References and Further Reading

1. What Is Self-Deception?

a. Conceptual Challenges

There is a vast literature on the nature and possibility of self-deception. And given the state of the debate, it seems unlikely that philosophers will soon agree upon one account of self-deception. This may be due, in part, to the fact that we ordinarily use the term, “self-deception”, in a broad and flexible way. But it is also the case that our various experiences with self-deception shape our thoughts about the paradigmatic self-deceiver. We can view much of the work on the nature of self-deception as a response to its apparently paradoxical nature. If self-deception is structurally similar to interpersonal deception, then it would seem that the self-deceiver must A) intentionally bring about the self-deception, and B) hold a pair of contradictory beliefs. Theorists who accept this model claim that deception is, by definition, an intentional phenomenon; that is, one person cannot deceive another without intending to do so. They also maintain that deception always involves contradictory beliefs; that is, a deceiver believes that p and brings it about that the deceived believes that not-p. And since the self-deceiver plays the role of the deceiver, and the deceived, he must believe both that p and that not-p. Suppose, for example, that William is self-deceived about his talent as a writer and believes that he will be the world’s next Marcel Proust. If this is true, then William must hold contradictory beliefs regarding his talent; that is, he must believe both that he will be the world’s next Proust, and that he will not be the world’s next Proust. Moreover, as per condition A, it must be the case that he intentionally brings it about that he holds the former (desirable) belief. But it not obvious that a single person can satisfy both of these conditions. Each of these conditions generates a “puzzle” or “paradox” when applied to cases of self-deception. Condition A, which gives rise to the “dynamic” puzzle, is problematic because it seems unlikely that a person could deceive himself while being fully aware of his intention to do so; for awareness of the self-deceptive intention would interfere with the success of his project (Mele 2001, p. 8). And condition B, which gives rise to the “static” puzzle (pp. 6-7), would be difficult to satisfy because it is often thought that believing that p rules out believing that not-p as well (see Goldstick 1989). Even if one thinks that it is possible for a person to hold contradictory beliefs, one might still be reluctant to accept that this can happen when the beliefs in question are obvious contradictories, as they are thought to be in cases of self-deception. Indeed, theorists who accept this model generally maintain that it is the very recognition that p that motivates a person to produce in himself the belief that not-p. What then should we conclude about the nature and possibility of self-deception?

b. Divided Mind Accounts

Some philosophers respond to these puzzles by denying that strict or literal self-deception is possible (see Haight 1980). Other philosophers, such as Donald Davidson (1986, 1998) and David Pears (1984, 1985), have developed sophisticated accounts of self-deception that embrace conditions A and B, but avoid—or so they claim—the two corresponding puzzles. Both Davidson and Pears have introduced divisions in the mind of the self-deceiver in order to keep incompatible mental states apart, and thus preserve internal coherence. Pears, at times, seems to be willing to attribute agency (at least in some incipient form) to a part or sub-system that results from such divisions (see Pears 1984). But Davidson firmly denies that these divisions result in there being multiple agents, or “autonomous territories”, in the mind of the self-deceiver. Instead, he asks us to suppose that the self-deceiver’s mind is “not wholly integrated,” and is, or resembles, “a brain suffering from a perhaps self-inflicted lobotomy” (1998, p. 8). On Davidson’s model, it is possible for a self-deceiver to hold contradictory beliefs as long as the two beliefs are held apart from each other. We need to distinguish between “believing contradictory propositions and believing a contradiction, between believing that p and believing that not-p on the one hand, and believing that [p and not-p] on the other” (p. 5). If incompatible beliefs can be held apart in the human mind, then we can coherently describe cases of self-deception that satisfy conditions A and B.

c. Deflationary Accounts

Alfred Mele has rejected the two conditions for literal self-deception, and has developed a “deflationary” account of self-deception (Mele 2001, p. 4). His account of self-deception is based heavily upon empirical research regarding hypothesis testing and biased thinking and believing. He tries to show that ordinary cases of self-deception can be explained by looking at the biasing effect that our desires and emotions have upon our beliefs (pp. 25-49). A person’s desiring that p can make it easier for her to believe that p by influencing the way that he or she gathers and interprets evidence relevant to the truth of p. The ordinary self-deceiver does not do anything intentionally to bring it about that he is self-deceived. Rather, his motivational economy can cause her to be self-deceived automatically, as it were, and without her intervention. One of the ways that a person’s desires can shape the way that she forms beliefs is through what Mele calls “positive misinterpretation”. Positive misinterpretation occurs when one’s desiring that p leads him “to interpret as supporting p data that we would easily recognize to count against p in the desire’s absence” (p. 26). Mele illustrates how this can happen through his example of the unrequited love that a student, Sid, feels for his classmate, Roz. Sid is fond of Roz and wants it to be true that she feels the same way about him. Sid’s desire for Roz’s love may cause him to “interpret her refusing to date him and her reminding him that she has a steady boyfriend as an effort on her part to “play hard to get” in order to encourage Sid to continue to pursue her and prove that his love for her approximates hers for him” (p. 26). Positive misinterpretation is just one piece of Mele’s careful empirical study of the nature and aetiology of self-deception.

Annette Barnes (1997) and Ariela Lazar (1999) have also developed accounts of self-deception that reject conditions A and B. Lazar’s account emphasizes the influence that desires, emotions, and fantasy have upon the formation of our beliefs. Barnes examines the way that “anxious” desires affect what we believe, and cause us to become self-deceived. Barnes, unlike Mele, argues that the desires at work in cases of self-deception must be “anxious” ones. A person has an “anxious” desire that q when “the person (1) is uncertain whether q or not-q and (2) desires that q” (p. 39). For Barnes, self-deceptive beliefs are functional, and serve to reduce the self-deceiver’s anxiety (p. 76).

In dispensing with conditions A and B of self-deception, some theorists might worry that deflationary accounts do away with anything worthy of the name “self-deception”. On this view, what Mele et al succeed in describing is best understood as wishful thinking or a kind of motivated believing (see Bach 2002). They seem to fail to account for self-deception, which is a conceptually distinct phenomenon that is described by conditions A and B (or conditions closely resembling conditions A and B). José Luis Bermúdez (2000) and William J. Talbott (1995), who both defend “intentionalist” accounts of self-deception (that is, accounts that accept condition A but reject condition B), have individually argued that deflationary (and thus, “anti-intentionalist”) accounts cannot explain why self-deceivers are selective in their self-deception. Why is it that an individual can be self-deceived about his artistic talent, say, but not about the fidelity of his spouse? Bermúdez refers to this as the “selectivity problem” (p. 317). Mele is confident that his analysis and application of the “FTL model” for lay hypothesis testing (which combines the results of James Friedrich 1993; and Akiva Liberman, and Yaacov Trope 1996), can provide us with an answer to this question (Mele 2001, pp. 31-46). According to the FTL model, desires and corresponding “error costs” influence the way that we test for truth. When the cost of falsely believing that p is true is low, and the cost of falsely believing that p is false is high, it will take less evidence to convince one that p is true than it will to convince one that p is false (pp. 31-37). It follows from this analysis that individuals may test hypotheses differently due to variations in their motivational states (pp. 36-37). By way of example, Mele explains that

[f]or the parents who fervently hope that their son has been wrongly accused of treason, the cost of rejecting the true hypothesis that he is innocent (considerable emotional distress) may be much higher than the cost of accepting the false hypothesis that he is innocent. For their son’s staff of intelligence agents in the CIA, however, the cost of accepting the false hypothesis that he is innocent (considerable personal risk) may be much greater than the cost of rejecting the true hypothesis that he is innocent—even if they would like it to be true that he is innocent. (pp. 36-7)

On Mele’s view, we can make sense of the different responses that parents and CIA agents would have to the same hypothesis without introducing talk of intentions; for differences in motivation give rise to differences in error costs and, in turn, beliefs. Still, Mele’s critics may remain sceptical about the ability of FTL model to deal with the selectivity problem in its full generality. Can error costs alone determine when a person will, or will not, become self-deceived? Unimpressed by Mele’s treatment of the problem, Bermúdez insists that “[i]t is simply not the case that, whenever my motivational set is such as to lower the acceptance threshold of a particular hypothesis, I will end up self-deceivingly accepting the hypothesis” (p. 318). Clearly, there is still a great deal of disagreement concerning the intentionality of self-deception, and of motivationally biased belief more generally.

d. Other Approaches

There are numerous intermediate, and alternative accounts, of self-deception in the literature. Jean-Paul Sartre is well known for his existential treatment of self-deception, or bad faith (mauvais fois), and the human condition that inspires it. The person who is guilty of bad faith bases his decisions and actions upon an “error”; he mistakenly denies his freedom and ability to invent himself (1948, pp. 50-15). Consider Sartre’s provocative and well-known description of a woman who halfheartedly, and in bad faith, “accepts” the advances of a certain male companion. Sartre tells us that the woman is aware of her companion’s romantic interest in her. However, she is at the same time undecided about her own feelings for him, and so neither accepts nor rejects his advances wholeheartedly. She enjoys the anxious uncertainty of the moment, and tries to maintain it through her ambivalent response to his attempted seduction of her (1956, p. 55). Suddenly, though, the woman’s companion reaches for her hand, and with this gesture “risks” forcing her to commit herself one way or another (p. 56):

To leave the hand there is to consent in herself flirt, to engage herself. To withdraw it is to break the troubled and unstable harmony which gives the hour its charm. The aim is to postpone the moment of decision as long as possible. We know what happens next; the young woman leaves her hand there, but she does not notice that she is leaving it. She does not notice because it happens by chance that she is at this moment all intellect. She draws her companion up to the most lofty regions of sentimental reflection; she speaks of Life, of her life, she shows herself in her essential aspect—a personality, a consciousness. And during this time the divorce of the body from the soul is accomplished; the hand rests inert between the warm hands of her companion—neither consenting nor resisting—a thing. (pp. 55-56)

Sartre charges the woman in this example with bad faith because she fails to acknowledge and take full responsibility for her situation and freedom. Instead of committing herself to one choice or the other (that is, flirting or not flirting), she attempts to avoid both choices through a deliberate but feigned separation of the mental and the physical.

Herbert Fingarette, influenced by Sartre’s existential approach, has developed a theory of self-deception that is couched in what he calls the “volition-action” family of terms. According to Fingarette, we can make progress towards understanding self-deception if we replace the old “cognitive-perception” terminology with his new “volition-action” family of terms (2000, p. 33). Whereas the cognitive-perception family of terms emphasizes belief and knowledge, the volition-action family of terms highlights the dynamic and semi-voluntary nature of consciousness. Crucial to Fingarette’s active or dynamic conception of consciousness is the idea that a person can become explicitly aware of something by “spelling it out” to himself. When a person does this, he directs his attention towards the thing in question and makes himself fully and explicitly conscious of it (p. 38). Fingarette describes the self-deceiver as a person who cannot (or will not) spell-out an “engagement” to himself (p. 46). He is unable, or unwilling, to do this because the engagement in question challenges his conception of himself. He cannot “avow” this threatening feature of himself or the world, and so actively prevents himself from doing so. Moreover, the success of his project demands that he avoid spelling-out that he is not spelling-out a particular engagement in the world. In this way, the self-deceiver adopts a strategy or policy that is “self-covering” (p. 47).

Fingarette offers a plausible and insightful account of the motivation behind typical cases of self-deception. But some may interpret his shift in terminology as an evasion of the central issues that need to be discussed. Fingarette describes the self-deceiver as one who adopts a policy that is self-covering. But how is the self-deceiver able to adhere to this policy without noticing, or even suspecting, that it is his policy? Will he not find himself in the grip of the dynamic puzzle of self-deception? And what, on Fingarette’s model, should we make of the self-deceiver’s doxastic state? Does the self-deceiver hold only desirable beliefs about himself and his engagement in the world? Or is he confused about what he believes because he is engaged in the world in a way that he cannot avow? Fingarette seems to think that his new way of framing the problem avoids these questions altogether. But those who are not immediately sympathetic to Fingarette’s shift in terminology may find his account lacking in detail and clarity on these “key” points.

Also of interest here is Ronald de Sousa’s treatment of self-deceptive emotions. de Sousa has considered the possibility that we can be self-deceived not only about our beliefs, but about our emotions as well. In explaining one source of self-deception, de Sousa examines the way that various social ideologies influence the emotions—or the quality of the emotions—that we experience (1987, p. 334). In explaining how self-deceptive emotions are possible, de Sousa looks at the way that stereotypes shape the emotions that we experience. For example, according to certain gender stereotypes,

[a]n angry man is a manly man, but an angry woman is a “fury” or a “bitch.” This is necessarily reflected in the quality of the emotion itself: a man will experience an episode of anger characteristically as indignation. A woman will feel it as something less moralistic, guilt-laden frustration, perhaps, or sadness. Insofar as the conception of gender stereotypes that underlies these difference is purely conventional mystification, the emotions that embody them are paradigms of self-deceptive ones. (p. 334)

de Sousa adds that we cannot account for the emotions in question on the basis of socialization, or external social forces alone. Individuals whose emotions embrace these stereotypes are not simply socialized; they are self-deceived. And they are self-deceived, according to de Sousa, because they have internalized these stereotypes, and have allowed them to affect the character of what they feel (p. 336). To this extent, they are complicit and deeply involved in the modeling of their own emotions. Fortunately, we have some hope of freeing ourselves from gender stereotypes and other social mythologies through what de Sousa describes as “consciousness-raising”. By engaging in a process of critical review and redescription, we can challenge our assumptions and our view of the situation that is contributing to our emotive response (pp. 337-338).

Now how a theorist approaches the ethics of self-deception will depend upon the view of self-deception that he accepts. As we begin to explore the ethical dimension of self-deception, it is important to keep in mind that there is no single account of self-deception that has acquired universal acceptance among philosophers. At times, these points of disagreement will have a profound impact upon the way that we evaluate self-deception. This will become particularly clear (in Section 6) when we consider whether or not a self-deceiver is ever responsible for his self-deception.

2. Conscience and Moral Reflection

Self-deception is clearly a sin against Socrates’ maxim, “know thyself”. And many people find self-deception objectionable precisely because of the knowledge that it prevents a self-deceiver from achieving. As history has amply demonstrated, ignorance—no matter what its source—can lead to morally horrendous consequences. Aristotle, for instance, believed that temporary ignorance, a state akin to drunkenness, made it possible for the akrates to act against his best moral judgment (1999, 1147a, 10-20). Some scholars might interpret this ignorance as a convenient instance of self-deception that enables the akrates to succumb to temptation. One problem with this reading of Aristotle is that it is not explicitly supported by the relevant texts. But in addition to this, self-deception is generally thought to be a lasting, and not temporary, state. A fleeting spell of ignorance that surfaced and then quickly passed would probably not be best described as self-deception. If my moral judgment in support of vegetarianism is suddenly overcome by an intense craving for a grizzly piece of steak, I may be distracted and temporarily ignorant, but probably not self-deceived in my impaired state of mind. Sometimes, though, a person’s ignorance endures and shapes the way that he perceives himself and his situation. When this happens, we may have grounds for thinking that the person in question is self-deceived.

Bishop Joseph Butler regarded self-deception as a serious threat to morality, and treated it as a problem in its own right in his sermons on the topic. Butler was particularly concerned about the influence that self-deception has upon the conscience of an individual. Butler believed that the purpose of a human being’s conscience is to direct him in matters of right and wrong. A human being’s conscience is a “light within” that—when not darkened by self-deceit—guides a person’s moral deliberations and actions. According to Butler, self-deception interferes with the conscience’s ability to direct an individual’s moral thinking and action. And this, in turn, makes it possible for an individual to act in any number of malicious or wicked ways without having any awareness of his moral shortcomings (1958, p. 158). Butler warns that self-partiality, which is at the root of self-deception, “will carry a man almost any lengths of wickedness, in the way of oppression, hard usage of others, and even to plain injustice; without his having, from what appears, any real sense at all of it” (p. 156). Butler’s condemnation of self-deception is severe, in part, because of the gravity of the consequences that self-deception can bring about. The self-deceiver’s “ignorance” makes it possible for him to act in ways that he would not choose to, were he aware of his true motives or actions. And thus, self-deception is wrong because the acts that it makes possible are wrong or morally unacceptable. Morality demands that we reason and act in response to an accurate view of the world. Self-deception, in obscuring our view, destroys morality and corrupts “the whole moral character in its principle” (p. 158).

Adam Smith shared Butler’s concern about the “blinding” effect of self-deception, and its ability to interfere with our moral judgment. According to Smith, it is our capacity for self-deception that allows us to think well of ourselves, and to cast our gaze away from a less than perfect moral history (2000, p. 222). In this way, we can preserve a desirable but inaccurate conception of our character. Smith observes that

[i]t is so disagreeable to think ill of ourselves, that we often purposely turn away our view from those circumstances which might render that judgment unfavourable. He is a bold surgeon, they say, whose hand does not tremble when he performs an operation upon his own person; and he is often equally bold who does not hesitate to pull off the mysterious veil of self-delusion which covers from his view the deformities of his own conduct. (pp. 222-223)

Self-deception, for Smith, is an impediment to self-knowledge and moral understanding. If a person does not clearly perceive his character, and its manifestations in action, then he is less able to act morally, and to make amends for previous acts of injustice. Self-deception can also interfere with a person’s ability to progress morally, and to reform or refine his character. Both Butler and Smith recognized that even the most patient and careful moral reflection is wholly useless when it responds to a view of things that has been distorted by self-deception.

One worry that we might have about this evaluation of self-deception concerns its apparent neglect of instances of self-deception that do not concern moral issues. We are not always self-deceived about our immoral actions or motives. It is quite common for people to be self-deceived about their intelligence, physical appearance, artistic talent, and other personal attributes or abilities. And it is arguably the case that self-deception about these qualities often gives rise to positive or desirable consequences; that is, it may bring it about that the individuals in question are healthier, happier, and more productive in their lives than they otherwise would be (see Brown and Dutton 1995, and Taylor 1989). Mike Martin, in discussing Butler’s treatment of self-deception, has voiced this concern. On Martin’s view, self-deception does not always lead to negative or immoral consequences, but when it does we should be critical of it. His “Derivative-Wrong Principle” captures this insight: “Self-deception often leads to, threatens to lead to, or supports immorality, and when it does it is wrong in proportion to the immorality involved” (1986, p. 39). For Martin, self-deception is not always wrong in virtue of its consequences. But in evaluating the wrongfulness of any particular case of self-deception, we need to consider its consequences and the actions that it makes possible.

A second worry that we might have with the Butler-Smith evaluation of self-deception stems from the fact that we are not always self-deceived in the positive direction. We are often self-deceived in thinking that the world, or some part of it, is worse than it really is. Donald Davidson, in commenting on such cases, claims that if pessimists are individuals who believe that the world is worse than it really is, then they may all be self-deceived (1986, p. 87). But if pessimists have a more realistic view of things than the rest of us, as the research on depressive realism suggests, then we may want to resist this conclusion (see Dobson and Franche 1989). It may turn out to be the case that pessimists are the only ones who are not deeply mistaken about the world and their role in it. These possibilities certainly need to be considered when weighing the advantages and disadvantages of habitual or episodic self-deception.

3. Truth and Credulity

Thus far we have examined the way that self-deception can interfere with a person’s moral reasoning. But what should we say about the effect that self-deception has upon our general reasoning, that is, our reasoning about non-moral issues? Might we have reason to extend Butler’s concern about self-deception to other forms of reasoning? W. K. Clifford, in “The Ethics of Belief,” (1886) provided an affirmative answer to this question, and argued very passionately against any form of self-deception. Clifford believed that we have a moral duty to form our beliefs in response to all of the available evidence. It is therefore wrong on his view to believe something because it is desirable, comfortable, or convenient. Clifford supports this position by way of example. He asks his reader to imagine a shipowner who carelessly sends a dilapidated ship to sail. The shipowner is fully aware of the ship’s condition, but deliberately stifles his doubts, and brings himself to believe the opposite. As a result of his negligence, the ship, along with all of the passengers upon it, sinks in mid-ocean (p. 79). According to Clifford, the shipowner should be held responsible for the deaths of the passengers; for, as Clifford puts it, “he had no right to believe on such evidence as was before him” (p. 70). Clifford adds that even if the ship had successfully made its way to shore, the shipowner’s moral status would be the same, “he would only have been not found out” (p. 71). Believing upon insufficient evidence is always morally wrong, regardless of the consequences. And given that self-deception involves believing upon insufficient evidence, the same can be said of it: it is always morally wrong, regardless of its consequences.

Clifford was especially concerned about the effect that believing based upon insufficient evidence would have upon an individual’s (and society’s) ability to test for truth. He thought that believing based upon insufficient evidence would make human beings credulous, or ready to believe. A lack of reverence for the truth not only spreads throughout the life of a single individual—from moment to moment, as it were—it also spreads from one individual to another. In this way, humanity may find itself surrounded by a thick cloud of falsity and illusion (pp. 76-77). Philosophers have been critical of Clifford’s ethics of belief for a variety of reasons. Some have argued that there can be no ethics of belief because beliefs, unlike actions, are not under our direct control (see Price 1954), and others have worried that Clifford’s requirements for belief are mistaken or unduly strict (see James 1999, and van Inwagen 1996). In discussing Clifford’s specific thoughts on self-deception, Mike Martin has argued, contra Clifford, that not all cases of self-deception (or believing on insufficient evidence) lead to credulity, or a general disregard for truth. Indeed, many cases of self-deception seem to be isolated and relatively harmless (1986, pp. 39-41).

Immanuel Kant also expressed grave concern about the corrosive effect that self-deception has upon belief and our ability to test for truth. He refers to falsity as “a rotten spot,” and warns that “the ill of untruthfulness” has a tendency to spread from one individual to another (1996, p. 183). Although a person may deceive himself or another for what seems to be a good cause, all deception should be avoided because it is “a crime of a human being against his own person” (p. 183). When a person deceives himself or another he uses himself as a mere means, or “speaking machine” (p. 183). In so doing, he fails to use his ability to speak for its natural purpose, that is, the communication of truth (pp. 183-184). Kant’s categorical treatment of all forms of deception is the outgrowth of his particular version of deontologism. And his especially harsh criticisms of internal lies has its source in his views about the moral importance of acting from duty. For Kant, a person only acts morally when he acts from duty, or out of respect for the moral law. While we can never be certain that we have succeeded in acting from duty, we have an obligation to strive for this goal (p. 191). Through self-cognition, a person can examine his motives and possibly become aware of internal threats to acting morally. (Given that Kant believed that our introspection is fallible, the qualification is in order here). When he succeeds in his introspection, he will be in a better position to act morally from respect for the moral law. Self-deception is particularly problematic for Kant because it allows a person to disguise his motives and act under the guise of moral purity. A self-deceiver can comfort himself with his actions and with what he sees in the external world, and thus avoid the morally crucial thoughts and questions about the motives for these actions.

Kant’s limited remarks on self-deception are in many ways peculiar to his moral philosophy. But there is still a great deal that we can take away from his insights. Whether or not one is a Kantian, self-understanding seems to be something that is of value to most people, and to most (if not all) moral theories. Anyone who engages in moral reasoning will have to be concerned, if not suspicious, about the accuracy of the beliefs or motives that guide the process. Even consequentialists must concern themselves with the possibility that, as a result of self-deception, they may miscalculate the foreseeable consequences of their actions. John Stuart Mill (1910), for example, admitted that self-deception might interfere with a person’s ability to correctly apply the utilitarian standard of morality. However, he believed that self-deception, and the corresponding misapplication of a moral standard, presents a problem for all moral theories. In responding to this concern, Mill asks:

But is utility the only creed which is able to furnish us with excuses for evil doing, and means of cheating our own conscience? They are afforded in abundance by all doctrines which recognise as a fact in morals the existence of conflicting considerations; which all doctrines do, that have been believed by sane persons. It is not the fault of any creed, but of the complicated nature of human affairs, that rules of conduct cannot be so framed as to require no exceptions, and that hardly any kind of action can safely be laid down as either always obligatory or always condemnable. There is no ethical creed which does not temper the rigidity of its laws, by giving a certain latitude, under the moral responsibility of the agent, for accommodation to peculiarities of circumstances; and under every creed, at the opening thus made, self-deception and dishonest casuistry get in. (p. 23)

As Mill observes here, self-deception can interfere with the application of any standard of morality. For any standard that exists, no matter how rigid or precise, there is always the possibility that it will be misapplied as a result of self-deception. What we can conclude from this, according to Mill, is that the cause of the misapplication is not the standard itself, but the complexity of human affairs and our great capacity for self-deception.

4. Autonomous Belief and Action

As we have seen thus far, self-deception (for better or worse) can interfere with an individual’s reasoning in a number of ways. Kant, Butler, and (to a lesser extent) Mill are particularly worried about the influence that self-deception can have upon our moral reasoning. Some philosophers have suggested that by interfering with our reasoning, self-deception can decrease a person’s autonomy, where autonomy is understood (roughly) as rational self-governance. Marcia Baron considers the possibility that self-deception diminishes a person’s autonomy by causing him to “operate with inadequate information,” or a “warped view of the circumstances” (1988, p. 436). When one is self-deceived about important matters, one may suffer from a serious loss of control. The ability to make an autonomous decision requires that a person have a certain amount of information regarding the world and available options in it. If I lack information about the world, then I may be unable to develop and act on a plan that is appropriate to it (that is, the world), or to some feature of it. It has been argued, however, that a person who is self-deceived may not always be less autonomous on-balance than he otherwise would be. As Julie Kirsch has pointed out in evaluating the effect of self-deception upon a person’s autonomy, we may need to be sensitive to the self-deceiver’s values, and to the history of the case in question. Was the self-deception intentionally brought about? Did it serve to reduce a crippling spell of anxiety? And does the self-deceiver care more about his own self-esteem or “happiness” than about truth, or the “real world”? If a person engages in deliberate self-deception with his own interest in view, we may interpret his action as an expression of autonomy, and not necessarily as an impediment to it (2005, pp. 417-426). After all, while many of us do value truth over comfort, this preference seems not to be one that is shared by all individuals. Indeed, even truth-loving, tough-minded philosophers and scientists would probably rather be without certain pieces of information, such as the unsavory details surrounding their certain and inevitable deaths.

In examining the connection between self-deception and autonomy, we may also want to consider the extent or frequency of the self-deception. Clifford, as we have seen, believed that habitual self-deception could make a person credulous. Might it also (or in so doing) make him less autonomous? Baron warns that it might, and takes this to be one of the most troubling consequences of self-deception. She claims that self-deception gradually undermines a person’s agency by corroding his “belief-forming processes” (1988, p. 438). This may be true of habitual self-deception, but as we have already seen, not all self-deception is habitual. Self-deception can be isolated or limited to particular areas of concern. Baron’s analysis might seem more plausible, however, if we are willing to accept that self-deception is not always easy to control or oversee. Some theorists of self-deception suggest that the easiest or most effective way to deceive yourself is to do so with your metaphorical “eyes” closed, and to forfeit all control. Self-deception, on such a model, would be difficult (or impossible) to navigate because it relies upon processes that are necessarily blind and independent. As Amelie Rorty observes,

[c]omplex psychological activities best function at a precritical and prereflective automatic or autonomic level. The utility of many of our presumptively self-deceptive responses—like those moved by fear and trust, for example—depends on their being relatively undiscriminating, operating at a deeply entrenched habitual precritical level. (1996, p. 85)

If the success of a strategy depends upon its not being monitored, then the strategy and its reach may be difficult to control. In this way, a single case of self-deception may soon lead to others. This is why Rorty concludes that “[t]he danger of self-deception lies not so much in the irrationality of the occasion, but in the ramified consequences of the habits it develops, its obduracy, and its tendency to generalize” (p. 85). A single case of self-deception may seem prima facie to be innocuous and under one’s control. However, a look at its less immediate or long-term consequences may cause us to reject this initial evaluation as shortsighted and incomplete. In this way, self-deception may be analogous to smoking cigarettes or drinking alcohol. There may be nothing disastrous about smoking a cigarette or enjoying the occasional gin and tonic among friends. However, if one develops—or even begins to develop—the habit of smoking or drinking gin and tonics, then one might very well be on the way to developing an autonomy debilitating addiction.

5. Responsibility

Whether or to what extent we should hold a self-deceiver responsible for his self-deception will depend upon the view of self-deception that we accept. As indicated in Sections 1 and 2, there is a great deal of disagreement about whether self-deception is (sometimes or always) intentional. Theorists who think that self-deception is intentional will have grounds for holding self-deceivers responsible for their self-deception. If becoming self-deceived is an action, or something that one does, then a self-deceiver may be responsible for bringing this about (that is, he will be just as responsible for bringing this about as he would be anything else). To be sure, if the theorist does not think that we are responsible for anything that we do (say, because he is a hard determinist), then he will of course think the same of the self-deceiver. Matters become more complicated when the theorist in question (like Davidson 1986, 1998, and Pears 1984) also views the self-deceiver as divided, or composed of parts or sub-agents. How, then, should he evaluate the self-deceiver? Should he hold “part” of the self-deceiver, that is, the deceiving “part”, responsible? And view the other “part”, that is, the deceived, as the passive and helpless victim of the former?

Those who do not think that self-deception is intentional, may be reluctant to hold the self-deceiver responsible for his self-deception. Such theorists may view self-deception as something that happens to the self-deceiver; for, the self-deceiver does not actively do anything in order to bring it about that he is self-deceived. Still, even on this view, we might think that the self-deceiver has some degree of control over what happens to him. Although self-deception is not something that a person does, or actively brings about, it is something that he can guard against and try to avoid. If this is true, then we might be justified in holding the self-deceiver responsible for the negligence that contributed to his state of mind. But there are some who will be reluctant to attribute even this weak form of responsibility to the self-deceiver. Neil Levy, who describes self-deception as “a kind of mistake,” argues that we need to “drop the presumption” that self-deceivers are responsible for their states of mind (2004, p. 310). Levy maintains that we are often unable to prevent ourselves from becoming self-deceived because we fail to recognize that we might be at risk. In many cases, our failure to perceive warning signs will itself be a function of our motivationally biased states of mind. If I have doubts about a particular belief that I hold, then I might have reason to exercise a form of control against my thoughtless acceptance of it. However, if I am sufficiently deluded about the truth of my belief due to the force of my desires, then I may hold it without even a hint of suspicion or doubt. And thus, there will be nothing to prompt me to implement a strategy of self-control. If this is true, then it would be inappropriate for others to hold me responsible for my self-deception (pp. 305-310).

6. Conclusions

The philosophers that we have considered all express serious concerns about the effects that self-deception can have upon our moral lives. Butler, Smith, Clifford, and Kant have shown that our moral reasoning is only effective when it responds to the actual state of the world. And even when our moral reasoning is effective, self-deception enables us to hide our true motivation from ourselves, or that which prompts and guides our reasoning in the first place. But, as we have seen, self-deception is not limited to our desires, motives, and moral deliberations: we can deceive ourselves about the state of the world, the people in it, and even our own personality and bodily flaws. Self-deception, when practiced regularly, can serve as a kind of global anesthetic that immunizes us against the maladies of life. Most philosophers accept that severe and widespread self-deception is harmful and can lead to disastrous results. There is, however, comparatively less agreement about the wrongfulness of mild and localized cases of self-deception that simply boost a person’s ego, or add a touch of romance to an otherwise cold and loveless world. While some philosophers view such cases as harmless and even necessary, others view them as dangerous and destructive to human well-being and autonomy.

7. References and Further Reading

  • Aristotle, Nichomachean Ethics. Translated by Martin Ostwald (Upper Saddle River: Prentice Hall, 1999).
  • Bach, Kent. “Self-Deception Unmasked.” Philosophical Psychology 15.2 (2002), pp. 203-206.
  • Baron, Marcia. “What Is Wrong with Self-Deception?” In Perspectives on Self- Deception. Edited by Brian P. McLaughlin and Amélie Oksenberg Rorty (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1988).
  • Barnes, Annette. Seeing through Self-Deception (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997).
  • Bermúdez, José Luis. “Self-Deception, Intentions, and Contradictory Beliefs.” Analysis 60.4 (October 2000), pp. 309-319.
  • Brown, J., and K. Dutton. “Truth and Consequences: The Costs and Benefits of Accurate Self-knowledge.” Personality and Social Psychology Bulletin 21 (1995), pp. 1288-1296.
  • Butler, Joseph D. C. L. Fifteen Sermons Preached at the Rolls Chapel and A Dissertation upon the Nature of Virtue. Edited by Rev. W.R. Matthews (London: G. Bell & Sons LTD, 1958).
  • Clifford, William Kingdon. “The Ethics of Belief.” In Lectures and Essays. Edited by Leslie Stephen and Frederick Pollock (London: Macmillan and Co., 1886).
  • Davidson, Donald. “Who Is Fooled?” In Self-Deception and Paradoxes of Rationality. Edited by J.P. Dupuy (Stanford: CSLI Publications, 1998).
  • Davidson, Donald. “Deception and Division.” In The Multiple Self. Edited by John Elster (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1986).
  • de Sousa, Ronald. The Rationality of Emotion (Cambridge: The MIT Press, 1987).
  • Dobson, K. and Franche, R. L. “A Conceptual and Empirical Review of the Depressive Realism Hypothesis.” Canadian Journal of Behavioural Science 21 (1989) pp. 419- 433.
  • Fingarette, Herbert. Self-Deception (Berkeley: University of California Press, 2000).
  • Friedrich, J. “Primary Error Detection and Minimization (PEDMIN) Strategies in Social Cognition: A Reinterpretation of Confirmation Bias Phenomena.” Psychological Review 100 (1993), pp. 298-319.
  • Goldstick, Daniel. “When Inconsistent Belief Is Logically Impossible.” Logique & Analyse 125- 126 (1989), pp. 139-142.
  • Haight, Mary. A Study of Self-Deception (Suzzex: The Harvester Press, 1980).
  • James, William. “The Will to Believe.” In Reason and Responsibility: Some Basic Problems of Philosophy, 10th Edition. Edited by Joel Feinberg and Russ Shafer- Landau (Belmont: Wadsworth Publishing Company, 1999).
  • Kant, Immanuel. The Metaphysics of Morals, Cambridge Texts in the History of Philosophy. Translated and edited by Mary Gregor (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996).
  • Kirsch, Julie. “What’s So Great about Reality?” Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 3 (September 2005), pp. 407-427.
  • Lazar, Ariela. “Deceiving Oneself Or Self-Deceived? On the Formation of Beliefs ‘Under the Influence.’” Mind 108 (April 1999), pp. 265-290.
  • Levy, Neil. “Self-Deception and Moral Responsibility.” Ratio, 3 (September 2004), pp. 294-311.
  • Martin, Mike. Self-Deception and Morality (Lawrence: University of Kansas Press, 1986).
  • Mele, Alfred. Self-Deception Unmasked (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2001).
  • Mill, John Stuart. Utilitarianism (London: J. M. Dent & Sons LTD, 1910).
  • Pears, David. Motivated Irrationality (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1984).
  • Pears, David. “The Goals and Strategies of Self-Deception.” In The Multiples Self. Edited by Jon Elster (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985).
  • Price, H. H. “Belief and Will.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume, 28 (1954), pp. 1-26.
  • Rorty, Amelie Oksenberg. “User-Friendly Self-Deception: A Traveler’s Manual.” In Self and Deception: A Cross-Cultural Philosophical Enquiry. Edited by Roger T. Ames and Wimal Dissanayake (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1996).
  • Sartre, Jean-Paul. Existentialism and Humanism. Translated by Philip Mariet (US: Mathuen, 1948).
  • Sartre, Jean-Paul. Being and Nothingness; A Phenomenological Essay on Ontology. Translated by Hazel E. Barnes (New York: Washington Square Press, 1956).
  • Smith, Adam. The Theory of Moral Sentiments (Amherst: Prometheus Books, 2000).
  • Talbott, William J. “Intentional Self-Deception in a Single Coherent Self.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 55 (March 1995), pp. 27-74.
  • Taylor, Shelley E. Positive Illusions: Creative Self-Deception and the Healthy Mind (Basic Books, Inc., Publishers, 1989).
  • Trope Yaacov and Akiva Liberman. “Social Hypothesis Testing: Cognitive and Motivational Mechanisms.” In Social Psychology: Handbook of Basic Principles. Edited by E. Higgins and A. Kruglanski (New York: Guilford Press, 1996).
  • van Inwagen, Peter. “It Is Wrong, Everywhere, Always, and for Anyone, to Believe Anything upon Insufficient Evidence.” In Faith, Freedom, and Rationality: Philosophy of Religion Today. Edited by Jeff Jordan and Daniel Howard-Snyder (London: Rowman & Littlefield, 1996).

Author Information

Julie Kirsch
Email: kirschj@dyc.edu
D’Youville College
U. S. A.

Sense-Data

Experiences of all kinds have a distinctive character, which marks them out as intrinsically different from states of consciousness such as thinking. A plausible view is that the difference should be accounted for by the fact that, in having an experience, the subject is somehow immediately aware of a range of phenomenal qualities. For example, in seeing, grasping and tasting an apple, the subject may be aware of a red and green spherical shape, a certain feeling of smoothness to touch, and a sweet sensation. Such phenomenal qualities are also immediately present in hallucinations. According to the sense-data theory, phenomenal qualities belong to items called “sense-data.” In having a perceptual experience the subject is directly aware of, or acquainted with, a sense-datum, even if the experience is illusory or hallucinatory. The sense-datum is an object immediately present in experience. It has the qualities it appears to have.

A controversial issue is whether sense-data have real, concrete existence. Depending upon the version of the sense-data theory adopted, sense-data may or may not be identical with aspects of external physical objects; they may or may not be entities that exist privately in the subject’s mind. Usually, however, sense-data are interpreted to be distinct from the external physical objects we perceive. The leading view, in so far as the notion is appealed to in current philosophy, is that an awareness of (or acquaintance with) sense-data somehow mediates the subject’s perception of mind-independent physical objects. The sense-datum is the bearer of the phenomenal qualities that the subject is immediately aware of.

Knowledge of sense-data has often been taken to be the foundation upon which all other knowledge of the world is based. For a variety of different reasons that will be explored below, the notion of sense-data is now widely held to give rise to a number of difficult, if not insurmountable, problems.

Table of Contents

  1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data
  2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data
  3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data
  4. The Objections to Sense-Data
    1. Phenomenological Objections
    2. Coherence Objections
    3. Epistemological Objections
  5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data
    1. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea
    2. The Class of Sense-Data
    3. Awareness as a Real Relation
    4. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing
  6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions
    1. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism
    2. Adverbialism
    3. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience
  7. Critical Realism
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Books and Articles
    2. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data

Sense-data were originally introduced in order to account for a number of puzzling perceptual phenomena. Before we reflect upon the matter, we are inclined to take perception to be direct and straightforward. If I see an apple in front of me in broad daylight, the natural assumption is that the very apple I see is immediately present in my experience. In normal circumstances an object appears as it really is. I believe that the properties I am aware of in my experience, such as the roughly spherical shape, and red and green color, belong to the apple in front of me. There are, however, two main lines of argument that suggest matters are not quite as straightforward as common sense assumes:

The first general type of argument emphasizes epistemological considerations, and focuses on questions about whether our perceptually based claims about the world can be properly justified, and whether, through experience, we can arrive at any knowledge of the world that is beyond doubt. If our goal is to arrive at certain knowledge about the nature of the real world, then one suggestion, in line with empiricist views, is that we should begin with what is immediately given in experience. There are, however, difficulties attaching to the view that our perceptual experiences provide us with knowledge of a mind-independent physical world. It is suggested by advocates of sense-data (and others) that claims about the world that are based upon experience cannot be certain. The reason is that experience is not always a reliable guide to how things really are. Various perceptual phenomena raise prima facie puzzles about how our experiences can give us genuine knowledge of a mind-independent reality.

In perceptual illusions, by definition, some physical object is perceived, but the way an object appears to the perceiving subject is not how it really is. Thus in certain lighting conditions a red object can appear green; a straight stick, half immersed in water, will appear crooked; the whistle of an approaching train sounds a higher pitch than it really is. In hallucinations, there is no object at all present that is relevant to how things appear to a subject: someone who has taken drugs may seem to see a strange animal, when there are no animals present in the vicinity. In double vision, an object appears to be situated in more than one location relative to the subject. In most of these cases we are not usually deceived as to how things really are. However, the fact remains that in such cases things appear differently from the way they really are. These two puzzle cases—illusions and hallucinations–were often assumed to raise epistemological issues, about how we come to have knowledge about the world, and about whether we are justified in the perceptual judgments we make about the physical objects in our surroundings.

One motive, therefore, for introducing the notion of sense-data, involves the epistemic claim that there is a certainty attaching to propositions about experience, which propositions about the physical world are thought to lack. Under the influence of “the argument from illusion” (discussed further below in section 3), some writers argued that the phenomenal qualities that appear immediately to the subject in experience belong to items that are distinct from physical objects. These items are termed sense-data. Propositions about the sense-data immediately present in experience are supposed to have a certainty that other empirical propositions lack.

A second line of thought suggests that the fundamental problems connected with perceptual experience are metaphysical, and concern the proper analysis of what perceptual consciousness involves, and how our perceptual experiences are related to the physical objects and events that we perceive. Reflection upon common sense, and, in particular, upon scientific extensions of common-sense knowledge, raises complex issues concerning the relation between our experiences and the objective world we perceive. When we reflect upon perceptual experience from an external point of view, and think about what is going on when another person is perceiving, then it is natural to conceive of the process of perception as involving a series of distinct, causally related events. In considering a subject of some experiment on vision in a laboratory, we may be lead to distinguish between the fact that an object X is situated in front of the subject, and the inner experience E that the subject has, as a result of looking in the direction of X. This external perspective on perceptual experiences can suggest the thought that perception involves a number of stages, linking what is situated outside the subject by a causal chain of neurophysiological events to the culminating experience E, which perhaps supervenes on the subject’s brain state. We can combine this thought with the idea that an experience of exactly the same type could have been caused in an abnormal manner, without the object X being present – the subject could have had a hallucinatory experience of the same type, supervening upon the same kind of proximal brain state, but triggered by a quite different distal cause, such as, for example, the ingestion of a drug.

This way of considering perception, called by Valberg “The problematic reasoning,” suggests that what a person is immediately consciously aware of in experiencing an object is something logically distinct from that object (Valberg, 1992, ch. 1; see also Robinson, 1994, ch. 6; but compare Martin, 2004). This reasoning is not dependent upon any particular detailed set of scientific theories about perception. It arises at a very general level. But, as Locke appreciated (1690, Book II, Chapter 8), taken in connection with more specific scientific arguments about the intrinsic nature of objects, it can invite the further thought that the properties which the sciences attribute to physical things are very different in kind from the properties we are aware of in experience. For, it might be argued, the properties that science attributes to objects are either basically spatial in nature, or involve special forces and fields (such as electromagnetic phenomena) that we do not observe directly; hence they are distinct from many of the phenomenal qualities that we are immediately aware of. Finally, science tells us that there is a time-lag between the moment of the event at the start of the perceptual chain, when information about the state of a physical object is transmitted to the subject, and the event comprised by the subject experiencing that object. I can, in some sense, see a distant star, even though that star may have ceased to exist before I was born. Thus a second motive for introducing sense-data appeals to the alleged distinction between experiences and the physical objects we perceive. Experiences, on this view, are to be analyzed in terms of the immediate awareness of sense-data.

Both the above lines of thought are supported by some of the phenomenological considerations that relate to our first-person, subjective point of view. The claim that all sense-data belong to the same class of entities, and should collectively be distinguished from physical objects, is based in part upon the supposed fact that experiences of different kinds share a degree of intrinsic resemblance. It is possible for cases of veridical perception, perceptual illusion, and hallucination all to share a subjective similarity. From the standpoint of the subject, such situations are, at least on some occasions, phenomenologically indistinguishable from each other. So, for example, if a person is aware of something red and round, and it seems to them that they are seeing an apple, it is possible that they are actually seeing an apple, or that they are suffering from some illusion, either of a green apple, or of some other object; or they may simply be hallucinating an apple. There may therefore be no physical object situated in the subject’s environment possessing the properties that the subject seems to see. Nevertheless, it seems that the properties of redness and roundness are in some way immediately present to the subject’s experience, in a manner different from belief. On the sense-data view, the experienced properties of visual redness and roundness are attributed to an existing item, a sense-datum, of which the subject is immediately aware, irrespective of whether there exists some matching physical object in the surrounding environment. The postulation of sense-data as items in common to the various kinds of experiences that we can have, whatever their status, explains their subjective similarity.

Considerations such as these, although not always explicitly formulated, nor always clearly distinguished, have prompted the introduction of the notion of “sense-data.” The general idea is that we need first to get clear about precisely what is present in immediate experience whenever we perceive a physical object. We should analyze experience itself, before any assumptions about reality are brought into play.

2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data

Sense-data can be characterized as the immediate objects of the acts of sensory awareness that occur both in normal perception, and also in related phenomena such as illusion and hallucination. The central idea is that whenever I have an experience in which I perceive, or seem to perceive, a physical object, there is something immediately present to my consciousness. This “something” is a distinct object, a sense-datum that I am aware of, which actually has the qualities it appears to have. There is a mental act of awareness that involves a relation to a distinct object (Moore, 1903 and 1913). This act of awareness is sometimes also called an act of “acquaintance” or an act of “apprehension”. Sense-data entities, although often interpreted as non-physical, have real concrete existence; they are not like imaginary objects, such as unicorns, nor like abstract objects, such as propositions.

Suppose, for example, I see, in the ordinary sense of the term, a red apple in normal daylight. Traditionally it has been held that there is a small range of sensible qualities belonging to physical objects that I am aware of immediately, without drawing any inferences (Berkeley, 1713, First Dialogue). Thus, for example, it is held that in seeing the apple, I am immediately aware of its color and shape; in hearing a bell, I am immediately aware of a certain volume, pitch and timbre (or tonal quality) which lead me to believe that I am hearing a bell. Other such sensible qualities include tastes, odors and tangible qualities.

According to the sense-data view, these sensible qualities are in fact phenomenal qualities that belong to the sense-data somehow immediately present to conscious experience. Thus in seeing the apple, I am in fact immediately aware of a visual sense-datum of a certain roughly round shape and red color, which may or may not be identical with some entity in the surrounding world. If I hallucinate a ringing noise in my ear, there exists some sense-datum, a sound that I am immediately aware of. Sense-data can be characterized by a set of determinate qualities belonging to different quality spaces. Visual sense-data thus have color, and also spatial properties, of shape, position, and perhaps also of depth. Auditory sense-data have pitch, volume and timbre, and so on.

There has never been a single universally accepted account of what sense-data are supposed to be; rather, there are a number of closely related views, unified by a core conception. This core conception of a sense-datum is the idea of an object having real existence, which is related to the subject’s consciousness. By virtue of this relation the subject becomes aware that certain qualities are immediately present. This means that sense-data have the following basic characteristics:

(a) Sense-data have real existence – they are not like the intentional objects of thoughts and other propositional attitudes; that is, they are concrete (as opposed to abstract) items, and the manner of their existence takes a different form from the existence of the content of a person’s thought;
(b) The subject’s act of awareness involves a unique and primitive kind of relation to the sense-datum: this relation is not one that can be further analyzed;
(c) The sense-datum is an object that is distinct from the act of awareness of it;
(d) Sense-data have the properties that they appear to have;
(e) The act of awareness of a sense-datum is a kind of knowing, although it does not involve knowledge of a propositional kind;

In addition, sense-data have often been claimed to have the following characteristics:

(f) Sense-data have determinate properties; for example, if a sense-datum is red, it will have a particular shade of red;
(g) Sense-data are (usually) understood as private to each subject;
(h) Sense-data are (usually) understood to be distinct from the physical objects we perceive.

Of these, perhaps the most important – and problematic – claim is (e), the idea that being aware of a sense-datum involves some kind of knowledge of facts about the sense-datum (see Sellars, 1956, Part I). Sense-data were originally introduced as the “direct objects” of such acts of awareness as occur in perception and related experiences. Talk of “objects,” it should be noted, is ambiguous. In the sense intended, sense-data are entities that have real existence, of a non-abstract form. This means that sense-data are not like the objects of mental attitudes such as desire, belief, and fear. Such mental attitudes or states are said to have intentional objects, and in so far as the state is concerned, need not be about objects that actually exist. If I am hungry, and desire an apple, and believe incorrectly that there is an apple in the fridge, then although no physical apple exists in the relevant sense, my states are described in terms of what they represent, or are about. The apple, which I falsely believe to exist, in fact lacks real existence, and has only what is called “intentional in-existence,” by virtue of my representing it in my mistaken belief (see Brentano, 1874). But if I see or hallucinate an apple, then according to the sense-data view there is an actual red object of some kind – a sense-datum – that has real existence.

The acts by which the subject is related to sense-data are therefore not representational in the way that thoughts are. They do not have a structure analogous to that of purely intentional states such as desire and belief. So the sense-data theory holds that when the subject has a visual (auditory, and so forth) sensation, there is some real two-term relation of awareness or acquaintance that connects the presented sense-datum to the subject’s mind. The sense-datum is not an abstract object in the way that a proposition is. Nevertheless, this act of awareness is supposed to be, at the same time, a form of direct knowledge of the sense-datum object. It involves some kind of understanding on the subject’s part. Knowledge of the sense-datum is not inferred from any prior conscious state.

Although acts of awareness are mental events in the subject’s mind, the actual sense-datum itself is not a mental item in the way that a pain might be held to be something mental. According to the original formulations of the view, a sense-datum is distinct from the subject’s act of mind, and the subject only becomes aware of it by entering into the unique relation of awareness to it. The sense-datum is therefore not necessarily connected to the subject’s mind: in theory, the sense-datum could exist independently of the subject being aware of it (see below in section 3). Nevertheless, since the awareness of a sense-datum is supposed to be in some sense “immediate,” statements about sense-data have been variously claimed to be indubitable, infallible and incorrigible; there is, however, no settled view as to the status of such claims.

The classical conception of sense-data fits naturally with foundationalist theories of knowledge. Firstly, sense-data can play a role as the entities a subject has some kind of awareness of before arriving at beliefs about anything else: knowledge of sense-data is supposedly antecedent to knowledge of the physical world, and constitutes the justification for beliefs about the existence of physical things. Secondly, sense-data can, on this view, play a role in the empiricist explanation of how, in general, words acquire the meanings they have – the idea being that either words stand directly for properties of sense-data, or can be defined by reference to such words.

3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data

The expression “data of the senses” and its cognates gained currency towards the end of the nineteenth century, particularly in the work of William James (see, for example, James, 1897). The concept of sense-data was refined in the work of Bertrand Russell, and G. E. Moore, prominent amongst the philosophers of this period who appealed to the idea. The view harkens back to the theory of sensory ideas or impressions put forward in the work of empiricist philosophers such as Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. However, Moore’s seminal paper, “The Refutation of Idealism” (1903), which introduced the act-object model of sensing, may be seen as the origin of the essential features of the modern sense-data view. The notion was extensively appealed to in metaphysical and epistemological discussions throughout the first half of the twentieth century, for example in the work of Russell (1912 and 1918), Broad (1925), and Price (1932), and particularly in the works of Ayer (1940, 1956) and other positivistically inclined philosophers.

Since a sense-datum is logically independent of the act of awareness whereby the subject is conscious of it, it follows that sense-data can, in theory, exist outside of consciousness, without any subject being acquainted with them. The general class to which sense-data belong are known as Sensibilia or Sensibles. A sensible becomes a sense-datum by entering into a relation of awareness (or acquaintance) with the mind of a subject. This initial characterization leaves open the precise relation that holds between sense-data and physical objects. The category of sense-data, according to the original formulations of writers such as Russell, Moore and Price, is therefore introduced in an ontologically neutral way (see in particular Moore, 1913; Price, 1932; see also Bermudez, 2000; though compare Broad, 1925).

The answer to the question, “Do sense-data exist?” is therefore complex. Strictly speaking, the answer comprises two stages. In formal terms, if the act-object analysis of experience is correct, it follows from the fact that experiences occur that there are such things as sense-data. Sense-data are the objects, whatever their nature, that are immediately present in experience. Thus, originally, the term sense-data was introduced as a quasi-technical term to help clarify exactly what experience involves, so as to enable us to explore the various puzzling phenomena mentioned above. According to this original conception of sense-data, it is therefore an open question whether sense-data can be identified with physical objects, or their parts (for example, for visual sense-data, the facing surfaces). More usually, however, the question “Do sense-data exist?” is interpreted to mean, “In normal perception, are we aware of sense-data entities that are distinct from mind-independent physical objects?” Given the facts of illusion, and other kinds of perceptual error, it was held by most theorists that sense-data could not be directly identified with ordinary physical objects, conceived of according to common sense; nor, for the same reason, could they be identified with parts of ordinary objects (such as facing surfaces, and so forth).

For many early advocates of the concept, including both Moore and Russell, sense-data were indeed understood to be distinct from physical objects. This treatment of sense-data was bound up with an acceptance of the argument from illusion.

The argument from illusion can be briefly summarized as follows: supposedly, what I am aware of immediately is just how things appear to me. When I see a red physical object that seems green (perhaps because of unusual lighting conditions), some entity exists in the situation that actually is green; it is this green item that is immediately present to my consciousness. Because of the difference in their properties, it would seem to follow that we cannot identify the presented green entity with the red physical object. So what I am immediately aware of is some different entity, a sense-datum, and not a physical object. The existence of such sense-data entities can then be appealed to in order to account for the similarity between veridical and hallucinatory experiences.

A number of replies have been developed to the argument from illusion, and it was debated at great length during the twentieth century (and indeed the argument itself goes back at least as far as Berkeley). A proper appraisal is outside the scope of the present discussion (see in particular Ayer, 1940 and 1967; Austin, 1962; and, for a recent clear and detailed discussion, Smith, 2002). More recently, as noted in Section 1 above, some writers have concentrated upon the causal argument for the introduction of sense-data: this argument suggests that since hallucinatory experiences are in principle subjectively indistinguishable from veridical experiences, all experiences must involve an immediate awareness of entities that belong to the same common kind. There must be a “highest common factor” shared by all experiences. Since I could have a given type of experience – say, of seeming to see a red ball – while hallucinating when no such physical object is present in my surroundings, the common factor cannot include an external physical object. The common factor is therefore interpreted as an experience involving an awareness of sense-data, a special class of entities that are distinct from all external physical objects. For such reasons it can be suggested that in some way the awareness of sense-data is either equivalent to, or supervenes upon, the subject’s brain states alone. Even in veridical perception the subject immediately experiences sense-data that are distinct from the distal object perceived (Grice, 1961; Valberg, 1992; and Robinson, 1994).

If sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, and it is held that they can never be identified with the ordinary physical objects outside the subject’s body, then the question arises as to how in fact sense-data are related to the physical objects that we assume make up the external world. According to the Causal Theory of Perception (sometimes called the “Representative Theory,” or “Indirect Realism”) sense-data are caused by the physical objects that in some sense we perceive, perhaps indirectly, in our local surroundings. When I see an apple, that apple causes me to be immediately aware of a sense-datum of a red and green round shape, a sense-datum that roughly “corresponds” to the facing surface of the real physical apple. Some writers have objected to the Causal Theory on epistemic grounds. It has sometimes been claimed that physical objects are made unknowable on the causal account, or that demonstrative reference to physical objects would not be possible if the theory was correct (for discussion see Price, 1932; Armstrong, 1961; and Bermudez, 2000; but for replies to this criticism compare Grice, 1961, and Jackson, 1977).

Another possibility, explored particularly by Russell, was the metaphysical thesis that sense-data might be equated with the ultimate constituents of the world. If sense-data can be understood in this way, then both ordinary common-sense objects, and hallucinatory images, might be constructed from them; and possibly even the self might be a logical construction out of such entities. Under the influence of the theory developed by William James known as “Neutral Monism,” Russell analyzes a physical object such as a chair as a series of classes of sense-data; the self is also analyzed in a parallel way, as a distinct series of classes of sense-data, some of which include the sense-data that make up the chair (Russell, 1918, Lecture viii). (What this view means, very roughly, is that sense-data are taken to be the basic constituents of the world. Statements about selves, and about physical objects, are supposed to be definable in terms of statements about sense-data, in much the same way that it might be held that statements about nations might be defined in terms of statements about lands and inhabitants.)

Other writers put forward the related theory of phenomenalism, a view which was first developed in detail by John Stuart Mill, although it was in fact briefly canvassed by Berkeley (1710, sec 3). According to phenomenalism, physical objects are thought of as constructions out of actual and possible sense-data. That is, a statement asserting the existence of a given particular physical object, such as an apple in front of me, is supposed to be analyzable in terms of statements about the sense-data experiences I am currently having of the apple, or that I would have if I were to reach out and pick it up. To say that there is an apple unperceived in the fridge is to say something like: “If I were to open the door of the fridge and if my eyes were open, etc, I would have sense-data of a reddish, apple-like shape, and so forth.” The idea is that any statement that on the surface appears to be about a physical object can, by analogous methods, be translated into a set of statements which refer only to actual and possible sense-data, and do not refer to physical objects. But how to fill out the phenomenalist analysis in a more detail, so as to avoid any circularity (and to remove any appeal to the “et ceteras”) becomes problematic: in the example briefly sketched above, the analysis of the unperceived apple makes reference to the fridge door, and also to my own bodily states, and hence is incomplete (for a discussion see Chisholm, 1957; Urmson, 1956).

A different, though related approach to the question, put forward in various forms by Ayer, held that there was no genuine problem about the ontological status of sense-data and their relation to physical objects. We should instead regard the issue as a question of finding the most useful convention for discussing the various facts relating to perceptual phenomena. According to this view, acceptance of the sense-data theory amounts to a decision to employ a certain terminology, without deep consequences for metaphysics and epistemology. Provided suitable adjustments were made elsewhere in one’s system, any theory of perception could be adopted. Alternative theories “are, in fact what we should call alternative languages” (Ayer, 1940; similar ideas were mooted by Paul, 1936). Ayer’s own preferred language was in fact very close to the phenomenalist analysis sketched above.

The idea of sense-data came under attack from three general directions: (i) from phenomenologically based criticisms, drawing upon some of the findings of Gestalt psychology (for example, Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949/50); (ii) from anti-foundationalist views emanating from the philosophy of science, which denied a clear-cut distinction between observation and theory (for example, Hanson, 1958), and (iii) from the standpoint of ordinary language philosophy and epistemology (for example, in the powerful critique presented by Austin, 1962). As a result of these combined attacks, in the second half of the twentieth century the notion fell into disuse, despite some careful subsequent defences of the idea (see, for example: Ayer, 1967; Sprigge, 1970; and Jackson, 1977). Nevertheless, although explicit appeal to the notion has now largely been abandoned, the core conception still exerts a powerful influence upon our ways of thinking about perception in particular and epistemology in general.

4. The Objections to Sense-Data

Objections to the view that sense-data exist in a form that is different from the existence of ordinary physical objects have been advanced on a number grounds. These objections fall into three broad categories.

a. Phenomenological Objections

There is a central phenomenological objection to the idea of sense-data, which can be formulated in various ways. The basic contention is that the postulation of sense-data entities runs counter to ordinary perceptual experience. My immediate experience, when in the normal case I look around me, consists in the awareness of “full-bodied physical objects” (Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949; see also the discussion in Austin, 1962). First-person perceptual judgments are not mediated; I am not aware of making inferences from a subjective awareness of sense-data to the objective judgments I form about physical objects.

b. Coherence Objections

Perceptual experience is indeterminate. If I briefly see a speckled hen, I see that it has some speckles, but I am not aware of it as having a definite number of speckles. According to the sense-data view, the sense-datum of the hen I am aware of necessarily has the properties it appears to have. Hence the sense-datum of the hen has an indeterminate number of speckles. Yet if what I am aware of when I see the hen is a visual shape, an actual existing speckled sense-datum, then surely it must have a determinate number of speckles; this seems to lead to the contradiction in the properties that we attribute to the sense-datum (Barnes, 1944; but compare Jackson, 1977).

There are no clear-cut identity conditions for sense-data, and hence no principled grounds for answering such questions as, how many visual sense-data are present in my visual field? How long do they last? To this objection the sense-data theorist might well reply that in this respect sense-data are not logically worse off than many other kinds of entity; the identity conditions of ordinary physical objects are similarly not clear-cut (Jackson, 1977).

A further problem consists in saying where sense-data exist. Are they in some private space of which only the subject can be aware? Or do they exist in physical space? If the former, we need to explain how private subjective spaces are related to a common public space. If the latter, then we need to provide some account of how the properties of sense-data relate to those of the physical objects which are situated at the same location (Barnes, 1944).

Upholding the sense-data theory has sometimes been held to entail an acceptance of the idea of a “Private Language,” a view that Wittgenstein argued to be incoherent. Wittgenstein’s views on this question are not easy to interpret, and a full assessment of them is outside of the scope of this article. He was prepared to accept the existence of inner states and processes, provided they were connected with outer criteria (Wittgenstein, 1953, remark 580, and footnote to 149). Other passages (such as 1953, remarks 398-411) suggest that the real target of his criticism is the “act-object” model of experience. If Wittgenstein’s ideas are accepted, this would appear to show the incoherence any foundationalist conception of sense-data, in which knowledge of sense-data precedes, and serves as the basis for other forms of knowledge (see also Sellars, 1956 and 1963).

Perhaps the most fundamental of the objections to the coherence of the notion of sense-data concerns the unique “act-object” relation that is supposed to link the sense-datum to the subject’s consciousness. Crucially, the nature of this relation is left unexplained. Attempts to explain the relation, it is claimed, lead to a regress (Ryle, 1949, ch. 7; Kirk, 1994). This objection is discussed more fully below, in section 5c.

c. Epistemological Objections

There is a general worry, originating in the work of Descartes and Locke, that the acceptance of entities equivalent to sense-data, when these are interpreted as distinct from physical objects, leads to problems in the theory of knowledge. If we are only aware of sense-data, and not of the physical objects themselves, how can we be sure that the properties of physical objects resemble those that appear to us? How can we even be sure that physical objects do exist? Isn’t the sense-data theorist saddled with a serious and insoluble sceptical problem about the external world? The acceptance of sense-data, it is argued, leads inevitably to idealism or scepticism. Such criticisms have been widely advanced, but it is not at all clear how cogent they are. On any theory of perception problems about the relation between appearance and reality can be raised; they do not attach only to the sense-data view (for some discussion, see: Armstrong, 1961; Jackson, 1977; Robinson, 1994; M. Williams, 1996).

5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data

a. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea

Advocates of sense-data have produced many responses to these specific objections to sense-data. But no adequate assessment is possible without a proper examination of the underlying features of the original sense-datum theory, which give rise to the various difficulties listed. All the objections above trace back to deeper tensions arising from three central claims that form part of the original conception of sense-data. These are first summarized, before being subjected to a closer examination:

Claim 1: Sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, whose members can in principle exist independently of acts of awareness:

Claim 2: The awareness of a sense-datum is a sui generis act of awareness, involving a two-term real relation between an act of mind and a particular existent:

Claim 3: The awareness of a sense-datum is a form of sensory experience that somehow provides the subject directly with knowledge of facts about the sense-datum:

These three features of the sense-datum theory will be examined in turn.

b. The Class of Sense-Data

Do all sense-data, defined merely as the objects of immediate awareness in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences, belong to the same ontological category? This question leads to a number of further questions: How are sense-data related to physical objects? Are some of the sense-data that occur in ordinary veridical perception identical with the ordinary physical objects we perceive, or are they in all cases distinct from them? Can sense-data have properties of which the subject is not aware?

Assuming that we can make sense of the idea of acts of awareness, and that the formal notion of sense-data as the objects of such acts can be given a clear meaning, the precise ontological status of sense-data is a further issue, a matter of some debate. It should not be assumed without further argument that they constitute a homogenous class, and that, for example, the type of sense-datum present in a hallucination is of the same type as that present in the veridical experience of an external physical object. As we have noted, in the original formulations of the concept, sense-data are initially introduced in a neutral way – the idea being that their exact ontological status is a matter to be investigated. As a consequence of the adoption of the act-object conception of awareness, sense-data are held to be, in an important way, distinct from the subject’s mind. To the extent that a sense-datum is present to experience, and the subject is aware of that sense-datum as having a property F, it follows that the sense-datum must have that property F; but arguably it is possible that the sense-datum also has some other property G of which the subject is not aware (Moore, 1918; Ayer 1945; and Jackson, 1977). It is therefore possible that, in veridical perception, what the subject is immediately aware of is a sense-datum that is in fact identical with a physical object, whereas in hallucinations the sense-data present are non-physical items (Bermudez, 2000).

c. Awareness as a Real Relation

How can the nature of the relation involved between the act of awareness and the sense-datum be further characterized? How is the intrinsic nature of the subject’s experience (in so far as this involves the very act itself) related to the properties possessed by the existing sense-datum object? Should the sense-datum present in experience be understood as a particular entity, distinct from the act of awareness (or acquaintance), or should it be analyzed as an aspect of the character of the act?

One of the most serious objections raised against the whole notion of sense-data is that the nature of the relation between the subject’s conscious act of awareness and the sense-datum object is obscure, and cannot be coherently explicated. If the relation is modeled upon perceiving, then the view leads to an infinite regress. For suppose we try to analyze the situation where S sees some physical object X by the postulation of an additional entity, a sense-datum Y, such that in seeing X, S is directly aware of the sense-datum Y; suppose further, that the relation of direct awareness of a sense-datum is explained as similar to the relation of seeing an object; then by a like argument, in order to explain how S can be aware of the sense-datum Y, it seems that we must postulate a third entity Z, in order to account for the relation of S to Y, and so on ad infinitum. Of course, this regress can be blocked by denying that “awareness” (or “acquaintance”) is to be understood by analogy to perceiving, but this then leaves the nature of the awareness relation unexplained; all that can be said is that the relation of awareness is unanalyzable (Ryle, 1949; Kirk, 1994).

The problem here is exacerbated by the fact that such acts of awareness also have a peculiar metaphysical character that distinguishes them in general from other kinds of acts. Although the act is supposed to involve a two-term relation connecting two particulars, it also functions as a unique kind of “bridge” or link between consciousness and external items supposedly distinct from the mind. But it is hard to make sense of the claim that act and object are distinct entities. The act of awareness mysteriously “conveys” the phenomenal qualities of the object over to the conscious mind of the subject, making them present on the mental side of the relation, in the subject’s experience. It is not clear how any relation could play this role.

Connected with these problems is the issue of the status in the subject’s consciousness of the alleged acts of awareness. Moore himself drew attention to the fact that when I try to focus upon my act of awareness, all that I am aware of is the object of that act; I am not in any direct way conscious of the act itself. The act of awareness is supposed to be “transparent” or “diaphanous”: it is not something that is present in consciousness, when the subject is aware of its object. Introspection is of no help here, for even when I introspect I cannot discern anything other than the object I am aware of in having an act, the sense-datum. For example, when I see the oval petal of a blue flower, I am, supposedly, directly aware of a blue, oval shaped sense-datum. All that closer introspection of my consciousness reveals is just the very same blue oval shape that was there in the first place. So what grounds are there for saying that acts take place, acts that are distinct from their objects?

The act-object conception of the awareness of sense-data is also connected with a fundamental tension in the notion, concerning the extent to which the subject becomes aware of all and only the properties of the sense-datum. The tension is between the idea that the sense-datum has just those properties of which the subject is immediately aware of in being aware of the sense-datum, and the idea that there are further properties that belong to the sense-datum independently of whether the subject is aware of them. This tension leads to contradictory claims about the status of sense-data. Thus Russell held that sense-data are private to the subject (1914); more consistently, Moore held that it was an open question whether sense-data were private – this was not a feature of sense-data that followed automatically from the definition of the notion (1918). One attempt to avoid these various difficulties is the adverbial analysis of experience, discussed below in section 6b.

d. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing

In what way does an act of awareness, whereby a sense-datum entity is experienced, involve knowledge of the particular sense-datum that is present? How is the phenomenal (or sensory) aspect of experience related to the employment of concepts when the subject attends to the sense-datum and is aware of it as belonging to a certain kind?

Arguably the most fundamental difficulty arising from the notion of sense-data is the extent, and manner, in which concepts are involved in the awareness of a sense-datum. As Sellars pointed out, in many writings on sense-data there was an equivocation between treating the awareness of sense-data as, (i) an extensional non-epistemic relation between the mind and an independent existing entity, or alternatively, (ii) as a form of knowing (see, in particular, Sellars, 1956). On the former view, being aware of a sense-datum is an extensional relation; the subject is related by awareness to a real entity that has concrete (as opposed to abstract) existence. On this view, being aware of a sense-datum is not a form of knowledge; it is more like a state of raw, unconceptualized sensation. The emphasis is simply upon the qualitative nature of phenomenal experience. But, on the alternative interpretation, the awareness of sense-data as a treated as a cognitive state or process, in which the mind attends to and grasps what is immediately before it, in a manner that somehow involves a classification into kinds. On this later epistemic view, the awareness of a sense-datum seems to require the exercise of concepts of at least a low-level kind.

Russell was happy to classify the direct awareness relation of the mind to a particular existing object as knowledge. This form of knowledge was not considered by Russell to be propositional, although it did involve attention (Russell, 1914). However, if the view is taken that all knowing involves classification, and hence the use of concepts, the issue is not so clear, as C. I. Lewis pointed out in presenting an alternative to the sense-data account, a neo-Kantian dual-component view of experience (Lewis, 1929). If the fact that something seems red to me is accounted for by my having knowledge by awareness of a red visual sense-datum, this suggests that I am aware of it as red, and this seems to require that I have the concept of redness. Equally, for a subject to attend to a particular entity suggests that the subject is able to single out that entity out by virtue of being aware of certain of its properties, which seems again to require the use of sortal concepts, so that the subject can conceive of the object as a unity.

According to Wilfrid Sellars (1956, Part I), the classical sense-data theorists’ conception of awareness (or acquaintance) is an amalgam of two different lines of thought: first, that there is some phenomenal or sensory aspect that distinguishes states of perceiving or seeming to perceive from states of merely believing or thinking, and second, that there are non-inferential knowings, knowings not based immediately on any particular prior beliefs, which operate as the foundation or evidence for all other empirical claims. In order to begin to clarify the distinct issues involved, Sellars holds that we need to distinguish more clearly between (a) the phenomenal or sensory aspects presented in experience, and (b) the concepts (perhaps of a low-level sort), inclinations to form beliefs, and other intentional aspects of experience.

These points about the distinction between the phenomenal and conceptual aspects of experience are connected with the interpretation of the awareness of a sense-datum as a two-place relation between act and object, albeit an act of a non-intentional kind connecting two existing relata. In some manner knowledge originates in, and is intimately tied up with the conceptual aspects of perceptual experiences. Having a perceptual experience usually leads to a “perceptual thought,” an intentional state. Yet this fact does not necessarily imply that the phenomenal aspect of perceptual experience should itself be analyzed on the model of intentional acts, such as thoughts about states of affairs. Many of the objections listed above, particularly those pertaining to the internal coherence of the notion, stem from the conflation of sensing and knowing – a “mongrel” conception, as Sellars describes it, in which phenomenal consciousness is equated directly with conceptual consciousness (Sellars, 1956, Part I).

A related issue is the problem of how the term “immediately” is to be understood in attempts to explicate the notion of sense-data. The term is sometimes understood in a psychological sense, as connected with how things appear from a subjective point of view. The idea is that sense-data may be viewed as “immediate objects” of perception, in the sense that awareness of them is not inferred from any belief, and that sense-data, as defined, have a fixed small set of qualities. But then it can be objected that the sense-data view is simply false to experience: what I am usually immediately aware of when I look at an apple is just the apple itself, and not a simply a patch of color with a certain shape (Heidegger, 1968; Firth, 1949, 1950; Valberg, 1993). It is the notion of there being an apple in front of me that springs immediately to my mind when I see it – my mind is occupied with concepts relating to the physical object framework. Discerning the actual complex pattern of color and shape given to me in experience is something that requires special training and attention. Similar criticisms affect the closely related attempts to introduce the notion of sense-data by appeal to ideas such as certainty or indubitability (Price, 1932).

If the awareness of sense-data in itself is not a conceptual or propositional state, the question of inference or otherwise does not arise. A perceptual belief about the kind of object experienced would simply be causally related to a prior state of phenomenal consciousness. So, for example, it might be claimed that the non-conceptual awareness of a sense-datum prompts the subject to form a thought about the kinds of properties they are experiencing. If, alternatively, awareness is construed as propositional in nature, then this seems to undermine the original conception of sense-data as accounting for the distinctive phenomenal, or sensory, aspects of experience.

6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions

Many of the major subsequent developments in the philosophical treatment of perceptual experience can be seen as attempts to grapple with the tensions in the original notions of sense-data. Different lines of thought have been developed, according to which particular problem has been considered most pressing. There are four important approaches to the question of how perceptual experience should be analyzed that are particularly worthy of note.

a. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism

In recent times a number of philosophers have rejected the homogeneity assumption. They argue that there is no single common type of presented entity in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences. A claim of the form: “It looks to subject S as if there is an F present…” can be made true by virtue of two quite different situations. The objects that perceiving subjects are immediately acquainted with in normal veridical perception are just the very physical objects that common sense tells us exist. There are no other entities involved as perceptual intermediaries. In other kinds of case, such as hallucinations, and possibly also illusions, there may be non-physical entities present in consciousness that are in some sense qualitatively similar to physical objects, but this subjective fact does not mean that there is a deeper similarity at the ontological level. In refusing to allow any role for perceptual intermediaries in the normal case, this view amounts to the general theory of perception known as Direct Realism: veridical perception is understood to comprise a direct relation of awareness between a conscious subject and an object or feature of the external physical world. The perceptual experience of a physical object is a “simple relation” holding between subject and object (see, for example, Barnes 1940; Dretske, 1969; and Campbell, 2002). In virtue of its denial of a “highest common factor” shared by different kinds of experiences (see above, section 3d), Direct Realism has also been described as a form of “Disjunctivism,” although this latter term can have other connotations in connection with theories of perception (see Snowdon, 1980; and also Martin, 2002).

Direct Realism involves a rejection of the Causal Theory of Perception, where the latter theory is understood as attempting to reductively analyze perceiving into separate components, involving an experience that is logically distinct from (though causally related to) the object perceived. The Direct Realist view, however, still encounters the remaining two problems for the sense-datum theory highlighted above. In particular, clarification is required of nature of the non-causal simple relation of awareness that holds in the normal perceptual case. How does an external physical object, by virtue of causally connecting with the subject’s sensory systems, come to stand in a relation to the subject’s consciousness, in such a manner that the perceiver is made immediately aware of phenomenal qualities belonging to that object? In the absence of a positive account, the simple perceiving relation remains obscure, and the grounds for introducing it are unclear (Coates, 1998 and 2007). A further problem for this view is to make sense of the phenomenal or sensory similarity between the entities that occur in hallucinations and the objects that we are aware of in illusions and ordinary perception. We need to account for the fact that the sense-data which occur in hallucinations have phenomenal qualities that resemble those which occur in the direct perception of the sensible properties of physical objects. This problem becomes the more acute, to the extent that a scientific conception of objects and their properties is accepted.

b. Adverbialism

In an attempt to avoid the difficulty in providing a satisfactory explication of the nature of the awareness relation, it has been argued that appearances should be should be construed “adverbially” as states of the perceiving subject, rather than as involving a two-place relation (Ducasse, 1952; Chisholm, 1957). According to this view, it is more perspicuous to analyze certain types of statements, statements apparently about sense-datum particular entities and their properties, as implicit claims about the manner in which a subject experiences or senses. The relational interpretation of appearances should be abandoned.

According to this account, the awareness of an appearance of a certain kind should be modeled on the awareness of pains – pains are not distinct from experience, they are properties of experience. Whereas Moore held that, in seeing a red rose, the subject is acquainted with a red sense-datum that is distinct from the subject’s act of consciousness, on the adverbial view the sensation of red is construed as a state of the subject’s consciousness.

So a claim such as:

(a) S is aware of a red visual sense-datum

is to be analyzed by:

(b) S visually senses redly.

The idea is that (b) reveals more perspicuously the underlying logical form of the original claim (a).

As sketched out in this simple model, however, the proposed analysis is clearly defective. For we need to account for the way that more complex patterns of appearances are to be analyzed.

Suppose:

(c) S seems to see one object that is red and round and another distinct object that is blue and square.

For the sense-data theorist, there would be two sense-data involved, corresponding to the two objects apparently seen, with analogous properties; thus (c) would be analyzed along the lines of:

(d) S is aware of one sense-datum x that is red and round, and another sense-datum y that is blue and square.

But the simple adverbial view is unable to solve the problem of what “binds” the apparent properties together in the complex appearance presented to the subject. The only analysis forthcoming is:

(e) S visually senses redly and roundly and bluely and squarely

yet analysis (e) fails to distinguish between the initial appearance (c) above, and the quite different overall appearance, where the links between the properties are changed:

(f) S seems to see one object which is red and square and another object that is blue and round

Hence the adverbial view must at a minimum allow a subdivision of the contents of the subject’s mind into distinct states of sensing (Jackson, 1977; see also W. Sellars, 1982). So (c) now becomes analyzed as involving a state1 of sensing redly and roundly, and a distinct state 2 of sensing bluely and squarely. State 1 and state 2 should be construed as different aspects of a single subject, or as co-constituents in the subject’s mind. However, in whatever precise form the adverbial view is developed, it still leaves unresolved the issue of the way in which concepts are involved in perceptual experience.

c. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience

One other important development that took place towards the end of the twentieth century concerned what has become known variously as the representationalist view of experience, or as the intentional view (or intentionalism). This amounts to interpreting experience as a unitary representational state; seeing, hearing, etc, are fully intentional states whose structures in some way parallel that of thinking and desiring. The acts of awareness or sensing are interpreted no longer as involving relations to non-abstract existing entities, but are instead understood as involving special attitudes towards states of affairs that may or may not exist.

One extreme reductive version of this view was put forward by D. Armstrong (1961), who tried to analyze perceiving purely in terms of the acquisition of beliefs and inclinations to believe. An alternative non-reductive version was advanced originally by Anscombe (1965), and has been taken up in various forms subsequently by a number of writers. On this version, the phenomenal content of perceptual experience is distinguished from the intentional content of thoughts and beliefs, but is still understood to be intrinsically representational. For Anscombe, and others who adopt this view, experiences represent facts in a special sensory manner. A question such as, “What did the subject see?” can be interpreted either extensionally, as asking about the actual physical object seen – the material object – or intensionaly, as concerned with the way in which things looked to the subject. When we describe how things look to the subject, we characterize the content of the perceptual experience by reference to the subject’s viewpoint, and such descriptions need not be true of the material object, which is physically present in front of the perceiver. So the descriptions involved give the intentional object of sensation, but need not refer to any actual existing item. The intentional object of sensation has no more reality than the fictional object of thought that is involved in my thought about “Zeus.” Something like this intentionalist interpretation of experience has been associated with an alternative form of Disjunctivism (McDowell, 1982, 1986 and 1998; Snowdon, 1980; Harman, 1990, and many other authors).

A major problem for this view is to give a satisfactory account of the difference between the content of an experience such as: “seeming to see that there is something white nearby,” and the parallel thought: “thinking that there is something white nearby,” which has the same intentional content, describable in identical terms. I can seem to see that there is something white in front of me, and I can think that there is something white in front of me; when I compare the two states, I am subjectively aware that there is a vivid difference in my consciousness, even though I am representing the same states of affairs. If experiences and thoughts can have completely matching contents, there must be some further, independent feature of my consciousness in virtue of which they differ. It is not clear whether the representational view really does justice to the way in which experiences involve phenomenal or sensory qualities actually present in consciousness.

Some writers claim that the representational content of experience is non-conceptual, meaning that the subject need not exercise the concepts necessary to characterize the experiences they have (Tye, 1995 and 2000). There is an important ambiguity here in the term “non-conceptual.” This can be understood in something like functional terms, as relating to the way such states guide primitive or semi-automatic actions in creatures lacking fully conceptual states – in which case a nonconceptual state can be distinct from the phenomenal character of experience, and cannot help to explain the nature of the later. Alternatively, “non-conceptual” can be understood as relating to phenomenal consciousness, the feature that makes the difference between mere thought and experience. But then it is of no help simply to be told that this feature is representational in a nonconceptual sense – we are still stuck with the problem that the representational contents of experience and thought can in some cases match, and what has to be explained is the nature of the difference between them. We require an account of the difference between the way that perceptual content represents and mere thought represents. It is arguable that the difference between them involves some intrinsic phenomenal aspect of consciousness, something actually present in experience that has more reality than a merely fictional object like “Zeus.” As Geach notes, sensations have formal as well as representational properties (Geach, 1957, section 28). It is not clear that the parallel between perceptual experience and thought has been successfully made out on the intentionalist view (compare also Martin 2002).

7. Critical Realism

A final possibility that has been canvassed is some form of dual-component analysis of perceptual consciousness, which attempts to do justice to both the phenomenal (or sensory) aspects, and also the conceptual aspects involved in experience. Perceptual experience is analyzed as involving two quite different components: an intentional component involving the representation of the subject’s surrounding environment through the exercise of classificatory concepts (perhaps of a low-level kind), and a further non-intentional and non-conceptual phenomenal state, in virtue of which phenomenal qualities are made present in the subject’s experience. Although the phenomenal non-conceptual component is not understood as intrinsically representational in the way that a thought is, it can still be treated as in a weak sense representational; that is, the different aspects of the phenomenal component of experience can still be described as carrying informational content about those features of the environment that normally cause them to arise in the subject’s experience, and are thus identified by reference to physical states of affairs.

A dual component view can take many different forms. Indeed, acceptance of it is implicit on some versions of direct and naïve realism. But of course it can also be combined with versions of the Causal Theory of Perception, in which the subject’s whole experience is held to be in an important sense distinct from the object perceived. One leading exponent of this view was Wilfrid Sellars, who developed the Critical Realist view originally put forward by the group that included his father Roy Wood Sellars, G. Santayana, and A. O. Lovejoy (for the original statement of Critical Realism, see Drake (ed.), 1920). Sense-data are re-interpreted as phenomenal or sensory states of the subject; but this aspect is no longer analyzed as having an act-object form. Sense-data awareness is replaced by a type of one-place sensing state, a constituent or aspect of the subject’s mind, and such awareness does not involve a real relation between an act and a distinct object. This sensing (or phenomenal) state causally prompts a perceptual thought (or a “perceptual taking,” involving low level classification), which is an intentional state, directed on to objects in the external world. The experience as a whole – involving a phenomenal state, and also the exercise of concepts – is causally related to the physical object perceived (W. Sellars, 1956, 1977, 1982).

The distinctive feature of the critical realist account is the claim that the phenomenal aspect of experience guides perceptual thoughts directly about the objects perceived; importantly, such perceptual thoughts are not in normal cases of perception focused on the phenomenal state – they refer directly to the physical objects we think we see in our surroundings. In seeing an apple, I sense in a red and round manner, and this guides my perceptual thought that there is an apple in front of me. On this analysis of perception, the sense-data theorist is viewed as guilty of a psychological error, as well as a philosophical one: we do not form perceptual thoughts directly about our own subjective phenomenal states. Entities with some of the characteristics traditionally attributed to sense-data are held to exist in experience, but they should not to be identified with the objects of perception.

Sellars’ own view was originally formulated in the context of a complex overall account of the nature of language and the way in which we come to refer to mental states such as thought and sensing, and underwent important developments in later work. But an acceptance of something like the central Critical Realist thought can be seen in the work of many recent writers on perception (including, for example, Grice, 1961; Mackie, 1976; Millar 1991; and Lowe, 1992). One problem for the Critical Realist view consists in reconciling the duality of experience posited by the account with the phenomenological sense that there is a unity in experience. A second problem lies in showing how the subject’s perceptual judgments succeed in referring to objects that are not immediately present in consciousness.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Books and Articles

  • Anscombe, G. E. M., “The Intentionality of Sensation,” in Butler, R., (ed.) Analytical Philosophy: Second Series, Blackwell, Oxford, pp. 158-180, 1965.
  • Armstrong, D., Perception and the Physical World, Routledge, London, 1961.
  • Austin, J. L., Sense and Sensibilia, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1962.
  • Ayer, A. J., Language Truth and Logic, Camelot Press, London, 1936.
  • Ayer, A. J., Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1940.
  • Ayer, A. J., “The Terminology of Sense-Data,” Mind, 54, pp. 289-312, 1945.
  • Ayer, A. J., The Problem of Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1956.
  • Ayer, A. J., “Has Austin Refuted the Sense-Datum Theory?,” Synthese, 17, pp. 117-40, 1967.
  • Barnes, W. F., “The Myth of Sense-Data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 45, 1944.
  • Berkeley, George, Principles of Human Knowledge, 1710.
  • Berkeley, George, Three Dialogues Between Hylas and Philonous, 1713.
  • Bermudez. J., “Naturalized Sense-data,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 61, pp. 353-74, 2000.
  • Brentano, F., Psychology From an Empirical Standpoint, Dunker and Humblot, Leipzig, 1874.
  • Broad, C. D., The Mind and its Place in Nature, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1925.
  • Campbell, J. Reference and Consciousness, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 2002.
  • Chisholm, R., Perceiving, Cornell University Press, Ithaca, 1957.
  • Coates, P., “Perception and Metaphysical Scepticism,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 72, pp. 1-28, 1998.
  • Coates, P., The Metaphysics of Perception, Routledge, London, 2007.
  • Drake, D., (ed.), Essays in Critical Realism, Macmillan, London, 1920.
  • Dretske, F., Seeing and Knowing, Routledge, London, 1969.
  • Ducasse, C. J., Nature, Mind and Death, LaSalle, Illinois, 1951.
  • Firth, R., “Sense-Data and the Percept Theory,” Mind, 58 & 59, 1949/1950; reprinted in Swartz, R., (ed.) Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, New York, pp. 204-270, 1965.
  • Geach, P., Mental Acts, Routledge, London, 1957.
  • Grice, H. P., “The Causal Theory of Perception,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
  • Hanson, N. R., Patterns of Discovery, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1958.
  • Harman, G., “The Intrinsic Qualities of Experience,” in Philosophical Perspectives, 4: Action, Theory and Philosophy of Mind, 1990.
  • Heidegger, M., What Is Called Thinking?, tr. J. Glenn Gray, Harper and Row, New York, 1968.
  • Jackson, F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1977.
  • James, W., “The Sentiment of Rationality,” Mind, 1897, reprinted in his Essays on Pragmatism, Hafner Press, New York, pp. 3-36, 1948.
  • Kirk, R., Raw Feeling, Oxford, Clarendon Press, 1994.
  • Lewis, C. I., Mind and the World Order, Charles Scribner’s Sons, New York, 1929.
  • Locke, John, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, 1690; ed. Nidditch, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1975.
  • Lowe, E., “Experience and its Objects” in Crane, T., (ed.) The Contents of Experience, pp. 79-104, 1992.
  • Mackie, J., Problems From Locke, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1976.
  • Martin, M. “The Transparency of Experience,” Mind & Language, 17, pp. 376-425, 2002.
  • Martin, M., “The Limits of Self-Awareness,” Philosophical studies, 120, pp. 37-89, 2004.
  • Millar, A., Reasons and Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1991.
  • Moore, G. E., “The Refutation of Idealism,” Mind, 12, 1903; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
  • Moore, G. E., “The Status of Sense-data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1913; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, (1922).
  • Moore, G. E., “Some Judgements of Perception,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1918; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
  • Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1922.
  • Merleau-Ponty, M., Phenomenology of Perception, tr. Colin Smith, Routledge, London, 1945/1962.
  • McDowell, J., “Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge” in Proceedings of the British Academy, 68, pp. 455-79, 1982.
  • McDowell, J., “Having the World in View: Sellars, Kant, and Intentionality,” Journal of Philosophy, pp. 431-491 (The Woodbridge Lectures), 1998.
  • Paul, G., “Is there a Problem About Sense-data?” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 15, pp. 61-77, 1936.
  • Price, H. H., Perception, Methuen, London, 1932.
  • Robinson, H., Perception, Routledge, London, 1994.
  • Russell, B., The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
  • Russell, B., “The Relation of Sense-data to Physics,” Scientia, 4, 1914; reprinted in Russell, B., Mysticism and Logic, Unwin Books, London, 1917.
  • Russell, B., “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism,” 1918, reprinted in Logic and Knowledge, Marsh, R., (ed.), Allen and Unwin, London, 1956.
  • Ryle, G., The Concept of Mind, Hutchinson, London, 1949.
  • Sellars, W., “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind,” in Minnesota Studies in The Philosophy of Science, Vol. I: The Foundations of Science and the Concepts of Psychology and Psychoanalysis, Feigl, H. and Scriven, M., (eds) Minnesota University Press, Minneapolis, 1956.
  • Sellars, W., “Phenomenalism,” in his Science, Perception and Reality, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1963.
  • Sellars, W., “Some Reflections on Perceptual Consciousness,” in Selected studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy, Bruzina, R., and Wishire, B., (eds) Nijhoff, The Hague, pp. 169-185, 1977.
  • Sellars, W., “Sensa or Sensings: Reflections on the Ontology of Perception,” Philosophical Studies, 41, pp. 83-111, 1982.
  • Shaughnessy, B., The Will, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1980.
  • Shaughnessy, B., Consciousness and the World, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 2000.
  • Smith, D., The Problem of Perception, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2002.
  • Snowdon, P., “Perception, Vision, and Causation” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 81, pp. 175-92, 1980.
  • Sprigge, T., Facts Words and Beliefs, Routledge, London, 1970.
  • Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
  • Tye, M., Consciousness, Color and Content, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2000.
  • Urmson, J. O., Philosophical Analysis, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1956.
  • Valberg, J., The Puzzle of Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1992.
  • Williams, M., Unnatural Doubts, Princeton University Press, Princeton, 1996.
  • Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical Investigations, Blackwell, Oxford, 1953.

b. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

  • Crane, T., (ed.), The Contents of Experience, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1992.
  • Dancy, J., (ed.), Perceptual Knowledge, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1988.
  • Hirst, R. J., (ed.), Perception and the External World, Macmillan, New York, 1965.
  • Schwartz, R., (ed.), Perception, Blackwell, Oxford, 2004.
  • Swartz, R. J., (ed.), Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, Anchor, New York, 1965.
  • Warnock, G. J., (ed.), The Philosophy of Perception, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1967.

Author Information

Paul Coates
Email: P.Coates@herts.ac.uk
University of Hertfordshire
United Kingdom

John Duns Scotus (1266–1308)

duns-ScotusJohn Duns Scotus, along with Bonaventure, Aquinas, and Ockham, is one of the four great philosophers of High Scholasticism. His work is encyclopedic in scope, yet so detailed and nuanced that he earned the epithet “Subtle Doctor,” and no less a thinker than Ockham would praise his judgment as excelling all others in its subtlety. In opposition to the prevailing thought in metaphysics that the term “being” is analogical, Scotus argues that it must be a univocal term, a view others had feared would bring an end to metaphysics and natural theology. Scotus’s novel account of universals and individuation gained a wide following and inspired brilliant counterarguments by Ockham and Thomist opponents. Despite its flaws, his argument for God’s existence, perhaps the most complicated of any ever written, is a philosophical tour de force. Scotus’s distinction between intuitive and abstractive cognition structured much of the discussion of cognition for the rest of the scholastic period. In opposition to such thinkers as Aquinas and Godfrey of Fontaines, Scotus defends a moderate voluntarism in his account of free will, a view that would be influential into the modern period.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works
    1. Life
    2. Works
  2. The Subject of Metaphysics
  3. Distinctions
  4. Universals
  5. Individuation
  6. The Argument for God’s Existence
  7. Univocity, Metaphysics, and Natural Theology
    1. Background
    2. Problems Arising from Analogy and Equivocity
    3. Arguments for Univocity
  8. Cognition
    1. Intuitive and Abstractive Cognition
    2. Divine Illumination and Skepticism
  9. Natural Law
  10. Action Theory and Will
  11. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Texts in Latin
    2. Primary Texts in English Translation
    3. Secondary Literature

1. Life and Works

a. Life

No one knows precisely when John Duns was born, but we are fairly certain he came from the eponymous town of Duns near the Scottish border with England. He, like many other of his compatriots, was called “Scotus,” or “the Scot,” from the country of his birth. He was ordained a priest on 17 March 1291. Because his bishop had just ordained another group at the end of 1290, we can place Scotus’s birth in the first quarter of 1266, if he was ordained as early as canon law permitted. When he was a boy he joined the Franciscans, who sent him to study at Oxford, probably in 1288. He was still at Oxford in 1300, for he took part in a disputation there at some point in 1300 or 1301, once he had finished lecturing on the Sentences. Moreover, when the English provincial presented 22 names to Bishop Dalderby on 26 July 1300 for licenses to hear confessions at Oxford, Scotus’s was among them. He probably completed his Oxford studies in 1301. He was not, however, incepted as a master at Oxford, for his provincial sent him to the more prestigious University of Paris, where he would lecture on the Sentences a second time.

The longstanding rift between Pope Boniface VIII and King Philip the Fair of France would soon shake the University of Paris and interrupt Scotus’s studies. In June of 1301, Philip’s emissaries examined each Franciscan at the Parisian convent, separating the royalists from the papists. Supporters of the Pope, a slight majority that included Scotus, were given three days to leave France. Scotus returned to Paris by the fall of 1304, after Boniface had died and the new Pope, Benedict XI, had made his peace with Philip. We are not sure where Scotus spent his exile, but it seems probable that he returned to work at Oxford. Scotus also lectured at Cambridge some time after he completed his studies at Oxford, but scholars are uncertain about exactly when.

Scotus completed his Parisian studies and was incepted as a master, probably in early 1305. As regent master, he held a set of quodlibetal questions (his only set) within two years of his inception. His order transferred him to the Franciscan house of studies at Cologne, where we know he served as lector in 1307. He died the next year; the date traditionally given is 8 November. Pope John Paul II proclaimed his beatification in 1993.

b. Works

Scholars have made considerable progress in determining which of the works attributed to Scotus are genuine. Moreover, many key texts now exist in critical editions: the philosophical works in the St. Bonaventure edition, and the theological works in the Vatican edition. However, others have not yet been edited critically. The Wadding Opera omnia is not a critical edition, and the reliability of the texts varies considerably. Despite its title, Wadding’s Opera omnia does not contain quite all of Scotus’s works. Most importantly, what Wadding includes as the Paris Reportatio on Book 1 of the Sentences is actually Book 1 of the Additiones magnae, William of Alnwick’s compilation of Scotus’s thought based largely but not exclusively on his Parisian teaching. The Parisian Reportatio exists in several versions, but most of it only in manuscript. Scholars are still uncertain about the exact chronology of the works.

Early in his career, Scotus wrote a number of logical works: questions on Porphyry’s Isagoge and on Aristotle’s Categories, On Interpretation, and Sophistical Refutations. His Oxford lectures on the Sentences are recorded in his Lectura, and his disputations at Oxford are recorded in the first set of his Collations. Scotus probably began his Questions on the Metaphysics in the early stages of his career as well, but recent scholarship suggests that Scotus composed parts of this work, in particular on Books VII-IX, after he left England for Paris, and perhaps late in his career. Scotus also wrote an Expositio on Aristotle’s Metaphysics and a set of questions on Aristotle’s On the Soul, but more study is needed to determine their relationship with the rest of Scotus’s corpus.

While still at Oxford, Scotus began reworking the Lectura into his Ordinatio, a fuller, more sophisticated commentary on the Sentences. At some point, probably after writing Book 1 d.5, Scotus departed for Paris, where he continued his work on the Ordinatio, incorporating into later sections material from his Parisian lectures on the Sentences. These Parisian lectures exist only in various versions of student reports, and so are called the Reportatio Parisiensis. Scotus’s early disputations at Paris are recorded in the second set of his Collations. After his inception as master, he held one set of Quodlibetal Questions. Scotus’s Logica, which Wadding’s edition mistakenly includes as Question 1 of Quaestiones miscellaneae de formalitatibus (although Scotus wrote no such work), is a brief but important investigation of what follows from the claim that a and b are not formally identical, and supplements discussions of the formal distinction in the Reportatio and the Ordinatio. Scotus composed his famous treatise De primo principio late in his career. While it cannibalizes large chunks of the Ordinatio, it is nevertheless Scotus’s most mature treatment of the central claims of natural theology. Scholars are still uncertain whether one further work, the Theoremata, is genuine.

Scotus died just a few years after his inception, leaving behind a mass of works he had intended to complete or polish for publication. Nevertheless, he soon exercised as great an influence as any other thinker from the High Scholastic Period, including Bonaventure and Aquinas. Despite fierce opposition from many quarters, and in particular from Scotus’s admiring confrere William Ockham, the Scotist school flourished well into the seventeenth century, where his influence can be seen in such writers as Descartes and Bramhall. Interest in Scotus’s philosophy dwindled in the eighteenth century, and when nineteenth century philosophers and theologians again grew interested in scholastic thought, they generally turned to Aquinas and his followers, not to Scotus. However, the Franciscans continuously attested to Scotus’s importance, and in the twentieth century their efforts sparked a revival of interest in Scotus, which has engendered many studies of high quality as well as a critical edition of Scotus’s writing, eleven volumes of which are now in print. It remains to be seen whether Scotus’s thought will have as great an impact on contemporary philosophy as Aquinas’s or Anselm’s.

2. The Subject of Metaphysics

The medieval debate over the subject matter of metaphysics stems from various proposals in Aristotle’s Metaphysics. These include being qua being (Met. 4.1), God (Met. 6.1), and substance (Met. 7.1). The Islamic philosophers Avicenna and Averroes, powerful influences on Christian scholastic philosophy, are divided on the issue. Avicenna rejects the contention that God is the subject of metaphysics on the grounds that no science can establish the existence of its own subject, while metaphysics can demonstrate God’s existence. He argues instead that the subject of metaphysics is being qua being. We have a common notion of being applicable to God, substances, and accidents, and this notion makes possible a science of being qua being that includes God and separated substances as well as material substances and accidents. In his rejoinder to Avicenna, Averroes holds that the view that metaphysics studies being qua being amounts to the view that metaphysics studies substance and, in particular, separated substances and God. Because it is physics, and not the nobler discipline of metaphysics that establishes God’s existence, there is no bar to holding that God is the subject of metaphysics. Scotus maintains with Avicenna that metaphysics studies being qua being. Of course, among beings, God is preeminent: He is the only perfect being, the being on which all others depend. These facts explain why God occupies the most important place in metaphysics. However, what makes God a proper subject for metaphysics is not that he is God, but that he is a being. Metaphysics also includes the study of the transcendentals, which “transcend” the Aristotelian scheme of the categories. The transcendentals include being, the proper attributes of being (“one,” “true,” and “good” are transcendental terms, because they are coextensive with “being,” each signifying one of being’s proper attributes), and what is signified by disjunctions that are coextensive with “being,” such as “finite or infinite” and “necessary or contingent.” However, anything capable of real existence also falls under the heading of “being qua being” and so may be studied in metaphysics.

3. Distinctions

On Scotus’s view, in order to have an accurate grasp of the structure of created reality and the nature of God, and in order to answer such questions as what individuates substances or how a God with multiple attributes can still be simple, we must first have a clear understanding of the various sorts of identity and distinction that hold among items. What follows is a brief taxonomy of four key sorts of identity and distinction, with particular emphasis on formal identity and distinction, earmarks of Scotistic philosophy. For simplicity’s sake, I will speak below only of distinction and not identity.

1. A real distinction holds between two individuals, x and y, if and only if it is logically possible either for x to exist without y or for y to exist without x. For example, Ricky the cat and Beulah the cow are really distinct, as are your hand and your foot, and a substance and its accident such as Socrates and his paleness. In these examples, either x or y in each pair can exist without the other. Even the paleness can exist without Socrates, although only by divine power. However, God and any creature are really distinct, and while God can exist without any creature, no creature can exist without God. Hence for real distinction it is not necessary that both items in the pair be able to exist without the other.

2. A conceptual distinction results from intellectual activity and does not mark any distinction in the thing itself. Rather, our intellects create distinct conceptions of what is really the same. For instance, to adapt Frege’s famous example, our concept of the Morning Star is distinct from our concept of the Evening Star, and yet the Morning Star and Evening Star are really one and the same thing: the planet Venus.

3. Scotus recognizes the need for a distinction that lies between the real and the conceptual distinction, a distinction that has a foundation in reality and so is mind-independent and yet does not imply real separability. For example, the will and the intellect are really the same, for each is really identical with and inseparable from the soul. However, the will is a free power and the intellect is not, and this is not simply a matter of the way we conceive them. Some sort of less than real but more than conceptual distinction is needed to capture this fact. Scotus calls this sort of distinction the formal distinction. What are distinguished in this case are not things (res) but what Scotus calls “formalities” or “realities” or “entities” in one and the same thing. According to Scotus, x and y are formally distinct if and only if (a) x and y are really the same and (b) x has a different ratio (account or character) than y, and (c) neither ratio overlaps the other. So, although the will and the intellect are really identical, their accounts differ and are mutually non-inclusive, and so they are formally distinct. Likewise, there is a formal distinction between the common nature and the individuator, between a genus and specific difference, between the divine attributes, and between each Person of the Trinity and the Divine Essence.

Scholars are widely agreed that in his early work, at least in the Lectura, when Scotus speaks of distinct formalities in a single thing, he means to identify items that are ontologically robust enough to serve as property bearers. Hence, Scotus can explain a single thing’s having even contradictory properties F and not-F without running afoul of the Principle of Non-Contradiction by contending that the bearer of F is a distinct formality from the bearer of not-F, although the two formalities are really identical. For instance, human nature is common both in itself and in reality, while the individuator that contracts that common nature into Socrates is individual of itself, even though in Socrates the common nature and the individuator are really the same.

In some of his Parisian works, such as the Reportatio (notably 1 d.33) and Logica, Scotus appears to grow more ontologically parsimonious, holding that formal non-identity or distinction within a single thing does not imply absolutely distinct formalities in that thing. Gelber [1974] and Adams [1976] suggest that Scotus changes his mind in response to criticisms his teaching on the formal distinction may have sustained at Paris. Scotus’s mediaeval critics, writing after his death, warned that his account would ruin the doctrine of divine simplicity if indeed it posited a plurality of formalities in God. However, it is hard to tell whether Scotus did in fact change his mind. Both the Reportatio and the Logica maintain that if x and y are formally distinct, that implies that they are not absolutely but only qualifiedly distinct, for they have only a diminished sort of distinction. It is hard to tell from what Scotus writes, however, whether this diminished distinction is sufficient for allowing qualifiedly distinct formalities to bear properties. There is also some evidence that Scotus raises the same ontological cautions about formalities in his Oxford writings (see the admittedly ambiguous Ordinatio 1 d.2 p.2 q.1-4 nn.404-8), independently of any Parisian criticism targeted at his work.

4. Scotus recognizes yet another sort of extramental distinction, one that applies to such items as the color red, which can be deeper or paler, courage, which can be stronger or weaker, and being, which can be finite or infinite. These items vary in the degree, quantity, or intensity of their perfection, that is, in their intrinsic mode. Scotus calls the distinction between such an item and its intrinsic mode a modal distinction, explaining its difference from the formal distinction by contrasting intrinsic modes with differentiae. Each differentia contracting the genus virtue (for instance) into its various species has a different formal character from its genus. However, variations in the depth of one’s courage do not create new species any more than do variations in the intensity of red, in the strength of one’s desire, or in degree of being. Pale red and deep red share the same formal character, as do slight and powerful desires for the same object; they differ only in the degree or intensity with which they exhibit this character. The modal distinction, then, is an even lesser one than the formal distinction.

4. Universals

Medieval philosophers rely heavily on ontological classificatory systems—in particular, systems inspired by Aristotle’s Categories—to show key relations among created beings and to afford us scientific knowledge of them. The individuals Socrates and Plato belong to the species human being, which in turn belongs to the genus animal. Donkeys likewise belong to the genus animal, but the difference rational divides humans from other animals. The genus animal, along with other genera such as plant, belongs to the category of substance. That much is uncontroversial. What mediaeval philosophers debate, however, is the ontological status of these genera and species. Do they exist in extramental reality, or are they merely concepts? If they do have extramental existence, what sort of existence is it? Are genera and species constituents of individuals, or are they separated from individuals? It is with these questions in mind that Scotus articulates his account of common natures. In short, he will argue that common natures such as humanity and animality really exist (although they have a “lesser” existence than individuals), that they are common both in themselves and in reality, and that they combine with individuators, which “contract” them.

The chief obstacle to accepting Scotus’s account of common natures is that his view requires us to accept that there are realites—genera and species—that have a less than numerical unity. Accordingly, Scotus offers a battery of arguments for the conclusion that not all real unity is numerical unity. In one of the stronger arguments, Scotus contends that if all real unity were numerical unity, then all real diversity would likewise be numerical diversity. However, any two numerically diverse things are, as such, equally diverse. In that case, Socrates would be just as diverse from Plato as he is from a line. Our intellects could not, then, abstract anything common from Socrates and Plato. In that case, when we apply the universal concept human being to the two of them, we would apply a mere fiction of our intellects. These absurd consequences show that numerical diversity is not the only sort, and since numerical diversity is the greatest diversity, there must be a real but less than numerical diversity and a real but less than numerical unity corresponding to it. Another argument holds that even if there were no intellects to cognize it, fire would still generate fire. The generating fire and the generated fire would have real unity of form, the sort of unity that would make this a case of univocal causation. The two instances of fire, then, have a mind-independent common nature with a less than numerical unity.

Although common natures are not in themselves individuals, since their proper unity is less than numerical, they are not in themselves universals, either. Following Aristotle, Scotus holds that what is universal is what is one in many and said of many. As Scotus understands this account, a universal F must have the indifference to be predicable in a first mode predication statement of individual Fs in such a way that the universal and each particular are identical. As Cross points out [2002], the sort of identity at work here is representational: The universal F represents each individual F equally well. Scotus contends that no common nature can be universal in this way. True, a common nature has a certain sort of indifference: It is not incompatible with any common nature that it be contracted by some individuator other than the one that does in fact contract it. However, with the exception of the Divine Essence, which is predicable of each Divine Person, only a concept has the indifference to be predicable in the way a universal is predicable.

Although Scotus originates this distinction between universals and common natures, he finds his inspiration for it in Avicenna’s famous assertion that “horseness is just horseness.” As Scotus understands this claim, common natures are indifferent to individuality or universality. Although they cannot actually exist except as individuated or as universal, they are not individuated or universal of themselves. For this reason Scotus characterizes universality and individuality as accidental to the common nature and, therefore, as needing a cause. It is the intellect that causes the common nature to be universal by conceptualizing it under the mode of universality, that is, in such a way that numerically one concept is predicable of a plurality of individuals.

This account of really existing common natures that bear a certain priority over individuals might suggest that Scotus is reworking a Platonic theory of Forms. However, Scotus distances his own account from Plato’s. For one thing, Plato holds that the Forms are the highest realities, while the particular things that participate them are lesser realities. Although Scotus admits that common natures really exist—they have their own being (esse)—because they have a less than numerical unity, they have a correspondingly diminished being. Individuals, in contrast, have numerical unity, and so their being is not diminished: The individual Socrates has more being than the common nature humanity instantiated in him. Furthermore, Plato maintains that the Forms exist independently of the individuals that participate them and of the minds that think them. On Scotus’s view, common natures exist only as constituents of individuals in extramental reality or as concepts in the mind. It is true that among the constituents of an individual, the common nature has a certain natural priority over the individuator: The nature is common not only of itself, but even in reality. Even when it forms a composition with an individuator, there is nothing incompatible about its forming a composition with a different individuator. However, this natural priority does not imply that the common nature can exist independently of its individuator, and so Scotus is correct to distinguish his account from Plato’s. Although Scotus’s important disciple Francis of Meyronnes took pains to liken Scotus’s views to Plato’s, he did so largely by interpreting Plato as a Scotist, not by interpreting Scotus as a Platonist.

5. Individuation

Humanity is a common nature instantiated in both Socrates and Plato. Socrates and Plato, in contrast, are not instantiated in anything further. Scotus calls them “individuals” and “singulars” because they cannot be divided or instantiated the way humanity is. To put the matter another way, Socrates and Plato cannot be divided into subjective parts. What explains their individuality, however, is a matter of vibrant controversy among scholastic philosophers, and Scotus comes to his own influential answer to the question by investigating the merits and flaws of his predecessors’ answers.

Many of these predecessors, such as Aquinas, explain the individuation of material and immaterial substances differently. Accordingly, Scotus begins with a critical refutation of their views on the individuation of material substances and follows this with an account of individuation, applicable to both material and immaterial creatures, that avoids the criticisms plaguing these other views. His first move is to argue that material substance is not individual on the basis of its nature. As we’ve seen (see Section 4), such natures as humanity and assinity are common and have a less than numerical unity, so there must be something besides the nature that explains the individuality of Socrates or Brownie the donkey.

That explanation, according to Henry of Ghent, Scotus’s favorite foil, is a double negation. The first negation is vertical, so to speak. If the item has no subjective parts, that is, if there is nothing further into which it can be divided in the ways that animal and human being are divisible in this Porphyrian tree

scotus-01

then the condition of vertical negation is satisfied. The second negation is horizontal: The item is non-identical with anything “beside” it in the same species. Because Plato and Socrates satisfy both of these conditions, they are individuals.

Scotus objects that Henry’s account is, at best, incomplete. It is true that negations can be explanatory in some cases. Pierre’s absence from the café explains why I do not see him when I arrive there, for instance. However, in the case at issue, resolving the problem requires accounting for a thing’s formal incompatibility with instantiation (having subjective parts), and only a positive feature can explain a formal incompatibility. Moreover, appealing to a double negation only moves the question at issue one stage back. If a material individual cannot be further instantiated because of the double negation, we will still not have a full answer until we discover what explains why it has this double negation, and an answer to that question must appeal to something positive.

The most common scholastic views, espoused by such influential thinkers as Thomas Aquinas, Giles of Rome, and Godfrey of Fontaines, do explain the individuation of substances by appeal to something positive, such as actual existence, quantity, or matter. Scotus heaps arguments against each of these views, but here I will recount one argument aimed equally against all three of these candidates.

Because substance is naturally prior to accident, what explains a thing’s being in any hierarchical substantial ordering must itself be in the category of substance. For instance, Plato is an individual in the species human, in the genus animal. No accident can explain any of these features. The addition of accidents to the species human, for instance, would not produce any individual human, but just an accidental union of the substance human being and those accidents. Scotus lodges largely the same criticism against the view that actual existence individuates, since actual existence too is extrinsic to any creature’s nature and, therefore, accidental to it. Finally, although matter counts as substance and not accident, Scotus’ predecessors argued that it is not matter per se, but matter marked by quantity that individuates, and so Scotus understands the theory that matter individuates as likewise holding that an accident, at least partly, explains the individuation of substance.

The critical discussion of his predecessors leads Scotus to conclude that what explains a substance’s individuation must be something positive and intrinsic to what it individuates. Moreover, it cannot be something common, since what is common can exist in something other than what it in fact exists in, while what explains individuation cannot. Finally, it must fall into the category of substance, since when the individuator is added, the substance is complete. It is the final element in a substance’s metaphysical make-up. Scotus often draws a useful analogy between the individuator and the specific difference. The specific difference rational cannot be divided, and so when it combines with the genus animal to constitute the species human being, the species is indivisible into further species. Likewise, Socrates’s individuator combines with the common nature human to constitute the individual Socrates, who cannot be instantiated. The individuator adds nothing further to his essence, which his common nature fully contains: While it makes him Socrates, it does not make him human. Although Scotus’s account of this individuator appears to remain constant in his many writings, what he calls it varies across works and even within single works. He frequently speaks of it as “the individual entity,” but also as “the individual form” and as “the haecceity.” Perhaps because of its use by C.S. Pierce, this last term has become dominant in contemporary discussions of Scotus on individuation.

6. The Argument for God’s Existence

Although God is not the object of metaphysics, he is nevertheless its goal: Proving the existence and nature of God is what metaphysics aims at. Scotus offers several versions of his proof of God’s existence, all sufficiently similar in language, structure, and strategy to be discussed together. The summary below will not do justice to this argument, perhaps the most complex in all scholastic philosophy. In what follows, the argument’s structure is broadly sketched and some details are furnished of its most important and distinctive subordinate arguments.

Scotus’s argument unfolds in four stages:

A. There is (1) a first efficient cause, (2) a preeminent being, (3) a first final cause.

B. Only one nature is first in these three ways.

C. A nature that is first in any of these ways is infinite.

D. There is only one infinite being.

Scotus’s argument begins in a distinctive way. At stage A, he incorporates various strategies his predecessors used for proving God’s existence into a stage of his single proof: (1) There is a first efficient cause that produced all else but is itself unproduced; (2) there is a preeminent being, one whose nature surpasses all others; and (3) there is a first final cause or ultimate end. At stage B, Scotus argues that a being that has any one of these three primacies will have the other two as well. At stage C, he proves that a being with any of these primacies is intensively infinite. Finally, at D he concludes that there cannot be more than one being with this triple primacy. Since Christianity identifies God as the creator of all but himself, as the being whose causal powers sustain the universe, as the preeminent nature who is infinitely good, wise, and powerful, and as the ultimate end of all things, Scotus identifies the unique being whose existence he takes himself to have proved as the Christian God.

Much of the argument’s interest lies in the subordinate arguments for A1, partly because they serve as the foundation for the rest of the proof, and partly because of their intrinsic philosophical interest. Relying on the common scholastic assumptions that (a) no being can produce itself, (b) there cannot be a circle of productive causes, and (c) every production has some cause, Scotus argues as follows:

Argument I: The Non-Modal Argument for a First Efficient Cause

1. Some being x is produced.

Therefore,
2. x is produced by some other being y.

3. Either y is an unproduced, first producer or is a posterior producer.

4. A series of produced producers cannot proceed interminably.

5. Therefore,
the series stops at an unproduced producer, a first efficient cause that produces independently.

Thus far, Scotus’s argument is typical of those found in scholastic philosophy. However, as he recognizes, philosophers such as Aristotle think that infinite causal series are possible, and so premise (4) appears to beg the question. Scotus’s defense of this vulnerable premise brings a clarity and articulateness to the discussion of infinite causal regression that his predecessors never could muster. Scotus concedes that there can indeed be an infinite accidentally ordered series of produced producers, but there cannot be an infinite essentially ordered series of produced producers, and this latter is all he needs to establish to reach his conclusion. In an accidentally ordered series of causes, in which A causes B and B causes C, B depends on A to bring it into existence, but it does not depend on A in order to be the cause of C. For instance, even if Ricky the cat depended on Furry to sire him, Ricky may now sire kittens himself without any causal contribution from Furry. When philosophers admitted the possibility of infinite causal regresses, it is only accidentally ordered series they had in mind. On the other hand, in an essentially ordered series of causes, B depends on A in order to be the cause of C. For instance, on the mediaeval science that Scotus accepts, a human being depends on the sun’s causal activity to generate another human.

From this key difference between accidentally and essentially ordered causal series, two further differences follow. In an accidentally ordered series, A need not act (or even exist) simultaneously with B in order for B to cause C. Furry may be long dead, and yet his son Ricky can sire kittens. In an essentially ordered series, however, A must exist and act at the very time B produces C. Secondly, in an accidentally ordered series, the causes may be of the same nature (ratio) and order (ordo), while in an essentially ordered series the causes belong to a different nature and order. After all, cause A does not simply bring B into existence, as Furry does Ricky; nor does it make a partial causal contribution, the way Brownie the donkey does when he is hitched to a wagon together with Eeyore. Cause A’s current causal contribution is what explains the fact that B is capable of causing C. However, being of a different nature and order does not imply that A is a higher sort of being than B. Because he is alive, Ricky the cat is a higher nature than the inanimate sun, even if the sun, as a more universal cause, belongs to a different order.

Scotus offers several arguments for the conclusion that there must be a first efficient cause of an essentially ordered series, all of them problematic. In one, he argues as follows:

Argument II

1. If there were an infinite series of essentially ordered causes, the totality of things effected would depend on some prior cause.

2. Nothing can be an essentially ordered cause of itself.

3. If this prior cause were part of the totality of things effected, it would be an essentially ordered cause of itself.

Therefore,
4. Even if there were an infinite series of essentially ordered causes, the totality of things effected would be effected by a cause outside the totality.

This argument does not purport to establish that an infinite series of essentially ordered causes is impossible, but rather that even if there were such a series, there must be a first efficient cause of that series that lies outside the series. However, without further assumptions, the argument does not quite reach its goal: It concludes not that there is a first efficient cause, but only that there is an efficient cause prior to this totality.

Scotus’s most original argument is the following:

Argument III

1. Being possessed of efficient causal power does not necessarily imply imperfection.

Therefore,
2. It is possible that something possesses efficient causal power without imperfection.

However,
3. If nothing possesses efficient causal power without dependence on something prior, then nothing has efficient causal power without imperfection.

Therefore,
4. It is possible that some nature possesses independent efficient causal power.

5. A nature that possesses independent efficient causal power is absolutely first.

Therefore,
6. It is possible that there be an absolutely first efficient causal power.

Like goodness and wisdom, efficient causal power is a pure perfection, and so it is possible for something to have efficient causal power without imperfection. Because dependence is an imperfection, it is possible for something to have independent causal power. This being would not be a link in an essentially ordered series of causes, but would stand at the head of the series as absolutely first. At this stage, however, Scotus has established only the possibility of an absolutely first efficient causal power. That is because he will use this conclusion as the key premise in another version of his argument for God’s existence, in which he will try to demonstrate that an absolutely first efficient causal power actually exists.

Argument IV: The Modal Version

In another objection to what he has written so far, Scotus notes that his argument for a first efficient cause, even if sound, does not count as a genuine demonstration because its premises are merely contingent, even if they are evident. If an argument is to lead us to scientia, the highest form of knowledge, it must be demonstrative: It must contain necessary premises leading to a necessary conclusion. In reply, Scotus offers a reformulated modal argument constructed with necessarily true premises. Scotus reworks his entire non-modal argument for a first efficient cause, but he also notes that we may begin with the conclusion of Argument III:

6. It is possible that there be an absolutely first efficient causal power.

7. If a being A cannot exist from another, then if it is possible that A exist, A exists independently.

8. An absolutely first efficient cause cannot exist from another.

Therefore,
9. An absolutely first efficient cause exists independently.

If an absolutely first efficient cause did not in fact exist, there would be no real possibility of its existing. After all, since it is absolutely first, it is impossible for it to depend on any other cause. Because there is a real possibility of its existing, it follows that it exists of itself.

7. Univocity, Metaphysics, and Natural Theology

a. Background

Once he opts for the view that being qua being is the subject of metaphysics, Scotus argues further that the concept of being must apply univocally to anything studied by metaphysics. If the concept of being applied only equivocally to a group of objects, it would not have the unity necessary to serve as the subject of a single science. It does not help to follow the lead of Aquinas or Henry of Ghent and argue that the concept of being applies to the objects of metaphysics analogously, because in Scotus’s view, analogy is just a form of equivocity. If the concept of being applies to metaphysics’ diverse objects by analogy, in that case too metaphysics cannot be a unified science.

Scotus offers two conditions for a concept’s being univocal: (1) affirming and denying it of one and the same subject is sufficient for a contradiction, and (2) it can serve as the middle term of a syllogism. For example, we can say without contradiction that Karen’s sitting on the jury was voluntary (because she willed to go to court rather than to be fined) and that her sitting on the jury was not voluntary (because she felt pressured into service). In this case, we do not reach a contradiction because the concept voluntary is equivocal. Likewise, the syllogism

No inanimate objects are unfriendly.
Some photocopiers are unfriendly.
Therefore, Some photocopiers are animate.

reaches an absurd conclusion because the term “unfriendly” is used equivocally: While it is used literally in the first premise, it is used in a figure of speech in the second.

b. Problems Arising from Analogy and Equivocity

Scotus finds that unless the concept of being is univocal, both philosophy and natural theology come to ruin, a startling claim in light of the fact that the prevailing mediaeval view up to that time was that philosophy and theology would come to ruin if the concept of being was univocal. Mediaeval philosophers before Scotus commonly thought that the concept of being must be not univocal or equivocal, but analogical: While it is not a pure accident that it applies to such diverse items as donkeys (substances) and dispositions (stubbornness), as well as to both creatures and God, it nevertheless does not apply to these diverse items in the same way. If it did, then being would be a genus, and the various Aristotelian categories would not be fundamentally diverse, but just different species of a single genus. Aristotelian ontology, the foundation of mediaeval philosophy since Alcuin, would have to be scrapped and a new ontology developed to replace it.

The consequences for natural theology would be even direr. Without a univocal concept of being, it would be impossible to construct an a posteriori argument for God’s existence, one that took as its premises facts about the existence of finite creatures. Moreover, unless other concepts besides that of being are univocally applicable to God and creatures, then the sort of philosophical theology exemplified by Anselm and the scholastic thinkers who followed him, meant not just to establish God’s existence but to elucidate his nature, would be impossible. Their universal practice is to discover God’s nature—what God is like in himself—by determining which perfections are pure perfections, perfections that imply no limitation whatsoever. An absolutely perfect God must have all pure perfections and only pure perfections, and so any attribute implying limitation does not characterize God as he is in himself. To determine which are the pure perfections, philosophical theologians use some version of this principle, which has its roots in Anselm (Monologion 15): F is a pure perfection if and only if it is in every respect better to be F than what is incompatible with F. Accordingly, because goodness, wisdom, and power satisfy this criterion for pure perfection, while corporeality and mobility do not, God is good, wise, and powerful, but not corporeal and mobile. However, no one can use the Anselmian criterion to determine what God is like without using concepts that apply univocally to God and creatures.

Scotus explains why this is so in the course of the Ordinatio’s fourth argument for univocity. Either the account of a pure perfection is (a) proper to creatures and inapplicable to God, (b) proper to God and inapplicable to creatures, or (c) univocally applicable to God and creatures. On the first option, whatever pure perfections one discovers by the Anselmian criterion are applicable only to creatures and not to God, a view Scotus finds absurd, presumably because God would not then be the most perfect of all beings possible. The second option, however, entirely rules out using the Anselmian criterion to discover the divine nature. If pure perfections are proper to God, then we must determine which attributes are pure perfections by seeing whether or not God has them. In contrast, to use the Anselmian criterion, one first determines whether or not an attribute is a pure perfection and only then concludes whether it is applicable to God. Options (a) and (b) bring natural theology to a halt because they preclude the use of the Anselmian criterion to discover God’s nature, but no such problems arise if our concepts of pure perfections apply univocally to God and creatures.

In the generation before Scotus, Henry of Ghent, moved by many of the same considerations, had articulated his own unique solution to these problems, a solution that would form the starting point for Scotus’s discussion. On Henry’s view, the intellect can abstract from a cognition of this being, formulating two distinct, simple concepts of being: a concept of being as undetermined but naturally determinable to some sort, which applies to all creatures, and a concept of being that is undetermined and indeterminable—it is by nature unlimited—which applies uniquely to God. There cannot, however, be a single, simple concept of being applicable to all things. That is because every concept has its foundation in some reality, but because he is transcendent, God has no reality in common with creatures. Nevertheless, because these two distinct concepts are both concepts of undetermined being, our intellect cannot easily distinguish them and so conflates them into one confused concept. While this is, strictly speaking, an error, it is a fruitful error, allowing us to reason from knowledge of creatures to quidditative knowledge of God, even though God is transcendent.

We can see in Henry’s account an attempt to secure the advantages of maintaining that the concept of being is univocal without giving up the traditional view that the concept is analogical. Scotus is sympathetic to Henry’s goal. After all, if Henry were successful, then Scotus’s worries about the unity of metaphysics and the possibility of natural theology would disappear. Nevertheless, Scotus finds Henry’s view problematic because, if we accept it, we can reasonably call into question the univocal unity of any concept. If the intellect naturally conflates very close concepts, then how can we be sure that there is a unique concept human being that applies to both Socrates and Plato? There could well be two distinct concepts that we naturally conflate because of their great resemblance.

c. Arguments for Univocity

In reply, Scotus offers a barrage of arguments for univocity and disarms the objection that his view would require the dismantling of Aristotelian ontology. The first of his arguments in the Ordinatio is perhaps his most influential for establishing the univocity of being. Suppose a person P is certain of one concept, but doubtful about others. Because a single concept cannot be both certain and dubious, the concept P is certain of must be different from the ones P is doubtful of. However, P can be certain that God is a being, but in doubt about whether God is a finite or infinite being, a created or uncreated being. Therefore, this concept of being that P is certain of is different from all the other concepts (finite, infinite, created, and uncreated being), but included in them and therefore univocal (Ord. 1 d.3 p.1 q.1-2 n.27). Our concepts of radically diverse beings, such as God and creatures, substances and accidents, still must contain as a component a univocal concept of being. However, this does not imply that these beings are simply species of a single common genus. Instead, finite and infinite are intrinsic modes of being (see Section 3 above), not differences dividing it, and so it does not follow that there is any nature common to God and creature. Nor is finite being in turn a genus and the categories its species. Each category is fundamentally diverse, with substance prior to all non-substance categories (Ord 1 d.3 p.1 q.3 n.164). Despite this diversity, our concept of each category includes a univocal concept of being as a component.

Scotus can use this same argument to show the univocity of other concepts besides being, such as goodness, wisdom, and power, which are likewise attributed to God. The universal practice of natural theology, that is, metaphysical inquiry about God, confirms the argument’s conclusion by showing that natural theologians are committed to univocity. First, they apply the Anselmian criterion to discover which notions are applicable to God, a criterion whose use, as we have seen, already presupposes univocity. Once they have formed a list (for example, goodness, wisdom, power, happiness), they remove the imperfection connected with these notions in the case of creatures. Finally, they ascribe to these notions the highest degree of perfection and attribute them to God. What is important, however, is that throughout this process the formal notions remain the same whether applied to creatures or to God.

Scotus’s arguments for univocity do not rule out the possibility of analogical predication. In addition to a univocal concept of wisdom applicable to both God and intellectual creatures, there is a concept of wisdom proper to intellectual creatures, which specifies wisdom as finite and qualitative, and a concept of wisdom proper to God, which specifies wisdom as formally infinite. The two concepts are constructed of a plurality of components, some of which diverge, but each contains this identical component: the simple, univocal concept of wisdom. The same will be true of all analogical concepts: They will diverge in some of their components, but at their root will lie a simple, univocal component that they share. We can see how the concepts diverge only after we have noted what they have in common. Hence, although analogy is possible, it is possible only because of univocity.

We might worry that Scotus’s teaching on univocity threatens the traditional religious doctrine of divine transcendence, a doctrine Scotus himself endorses. According to that doctrine, God is wholly different from creatures, having no reality in common with them. However, Scotus’s teaching on univocity seems to imply that God and creatures have absolute perfections in common, since such predicates as “good,” “wise,” and “being” are attributable to God and creatures in the same way and the same sense. Scotus replies to the objection about divine transcendence by reminding us that his remarks on univocity constitute not a metaphysical doctrine, but a logical one. The metaphysical divide between God and creatures is a radical one, for God and creatures have no reality in common. God’s absolute perfections, such as his being, wisdom, and goodness, which are infinite, are utterly diverse from ours, which are finite. However, by removing from our concepts of absolute perfections those features that make them proper to God or proper to creatures, such as the modes finite or infinite, we can form “incomplete” concepts of absolute perfections univocally applicable to both God and creatures. The formation of such concepts, therefore, does not impugn divine transcendence.

8. Cognition

a. Intuitive and Abstractive Cognition

Scotus distinguishes two sorts of cognition. Cognition of a thing insofar as it actually exists and is present is intuitive cognition, while cognition of a thing that abstracts from actual existence is abstractive cognition. Some sensory cognitions are abstractive, as when one daydreams about pears ripe for the picking. This cognition conveys no information about the way any actual pears are. Other sensory cognitions are intuitive, as when one sees, smells, or touches a pear ripe on the tree. This cognition does convey information about these actually existing pears. More interesting, however, is Scotus’s application of this distinction to intellectual acts. We clearly have intellectual abstractive cognition. When the sensory powers furnish it with phantasms, the intellect can understand the natures of things, and that sort of understanding in turn makes scientific knowledge possible. However, one can have abstractive cognitions, even scientific knowledge of, saber-toothed cats and dodo birds without the slightest idea that they do not actually exist.

Do human beings also have intellectual intuitive cognitions? Sometimes Scotus seems hesitant to admit that we do; after all, in this life, at any rate, human beings cognize things intellectually through phantasms. However, in many passages he argues that we regularly cognize things intuitively. After all, if we did not have an intuitive cognition of things as actually existing, how could we reason about the particular objects around us? Moreover, since my intellectual acts are not directly accessible to my senses, the only way I could know them without reasoning inductively from their effects is by intuitive cognition. Finally, appealing to the principle that whatever a lower power can do, a higher power can also do, Scotus concludes that, because sensory powers are capable of both intuitive and abstractive cognition, so is the intellect. Scholars disagree about whether Scotus’s apparently conflicting claims about intuitive cognition can be reconciled, with Day [1947] arguing for consistency, Wolter [1990a] contending that Scotus changes his views over time, and Pasnau [2003] opting for inconsistency. Despite the problems about what Scotus in fact thinks, the distinction between intuitive and abstractive cognition itself exercised an enormous influence, most notably on Ockham, but on nearly all subsequent scholastic discussions of cognition, especially those devoted to certainty and skepticism.

b. Divine Illumination and Skepticism

At the end of the thirteenth century, the theory of divine illumination still had its defenders, although fewer and fewer. The theory had been widely accepted, thanks to Augustine’s many and powerful arguments in its favor. Even early in his career, Augustine had argued that purely natural processes cannot result in knowledge. A teacher’s discourse can lead us to true beliefs, but knowledge requires something further: One must “see” that what the teacher says is true, a sort of justification available only through God’s special illumination of the mind. Augustine’s arguments exerted their influence for more than eight centuries, despite opposition from such formidable opponents as Aquinas, who contends at the very least that no special divine illumination is necessary for knowledge. The illumination theory’s last able defender is Henry of Ghent, whose influential writings kept the theory alive until Scotus wielded his pen against it.

Henry argues that our cognition of things would fall short of certainty without God’s special illumination, for two reasons. First, when we cognize things intellectually by purely natural processes, our cognition stems from an exemplar that is itself changeable. With a changeable basis, our cognition must likewise be changeable and so not certain. Second, the other basis of our cognition, the human soul, is likewise changeable and therefore fallible. We can attain certain knowledge, therefore, only if we have access to the unchangeable, uncreated exemplar, which only God can grant by a special illumination.

Scotus offers some brief but influential objections to Henry’s version of the theory. Henry maintains that what is in the soul as a subject is mutable, even its own act of intellection; but if that is the case, then an illuminated intellection is itself mutable. In that case, even divine illumination fails to preserve the soul from error. Moreover, Henry contends that created as well as uncreated exemplars play a role in producing certain knowledge. However, because the created exemplar is incompatible with certainty, adding an uncreated exemplar does not achieve certainty any more than adding necessary premises to contingent ones in an argument results in a necessary conclusion.

These negative arguments take aim at Henry’s version of the theory of illumination in particular, not against any and every version of the theory. However, Scotus did considerable damage to any future attempts to formulate a divine illumination theory by undercutting its motivation. On his view, we do not need a theory of illumination to show that certain knowledge is possible. The human intellect, by purely natural processes, can attain it, and in four sorts of cases:

1. We can have certain knowledge of principles because they are self-evident through their terms. As long as one grasps the meaning of the terms, one immediately sees that the principle is true. For instance, anyone who understands the term “whole” and “part” has a certain and immediate grasp of the principle that the whole is greater than the part.

2. Experience can also result in certain knowledge, such as our knowledge that magnets attract iron. This sort of knowledge is partly grounded in the first sort, because it depends on our certain knowledge of the principle “Whatever results for the most part from an unfree cause is that cause’s natural effect,” which is self-evident through its terms. On the basis of this principle and experience, we can gain certain knowledge through induction.

3. We can have certain knowledge of our acts and mental states, such as whether we are understanding or willing. We can even be certain that we are seeing, Scotus contends. If I see a flash of light, but there is no light in the room, the species causing my visual act must still exist in my eye, and so I am genuinely seeing something, although not something outside my own body. The level of certainty we gain from knowledge in this case is no less than that we gain from grasping principles evident through their terms.

4. We can also have certain sensory knowledge, thanks to the same self-evident principle that grounds the certainty of induction. If the same object, always or for the most part, causes multiple senses to judge that it has property F, then we can be certain that the object really has property F. Even if the senses conflict, as when vision tells us that the distant Goliath is smaller than the nearby David, but hearing tells us that Goliath’s stentorian voice comes from a giant, we can still attain certain knowledge by appealing to self-evident principles to correct the erroneous judgment.

9. Natural Law

Scholastic philosophical theologians are taxed not just with solving philosophical problems and creating philosophical systems, but with doing so in ways consistent with Biblical religion. Now, Genesis reports that the holy patriarch Abraham set out to kill his own son and that the holy patriarch Jacob took two wives, while Exodus tells of midwives who lied to Pharaoh and yet were rewarded by God. For a scholastic thinker, these texts would naturally raise questions about the status of the natural law, especially that portion of it recorded in the Ten Commandments, or Decalogue. If, as the scriptures suggest, these agents did not do wrong in acting as they did, did they not, despite appearances, violate the natural law? Or did God grant a dispensation from the law?

It is with these issues in mind that Scotus offers his most revealing discussion of the natural law. According to Scotus, God has in fact offered dispensations from the law. Dispensation may take two forms: God can revoke the law, or God can clarify the law. However, even God is limited in the extent to which he can dispense. That is because the natural law in the strict sense consists of laws known through themselves on the basis of their terms. Because they are logically necessary truths, they cannot be revoked, at the very least. Scotus takes the first two commandments of the Decalogue to belong to the law of nature in the strict sense. The commandment to love God, for example, exemplifies the principle that what is best is to be loved most, which is known through itself. Even God could not make it licit to hate him.

The natural law in the broad sense consists of laws that are “exceptionally harmonious” with the natural law in the strict sense. These laws are not known through themselves on the basis of their terms; their truth value is contingent. Therefore, God can grant dispensations from these laws, which include all the commandments in the second table of the Decalogue. Unfortunately, Scotus does not explain what he means when he says that the law of nature in the broad sense consists of laws that are “exceptionally harmonious” with the law of nature in the strict sense, and his vagueness has inspired astoundingly different interpretations of his account of natural law.

In some texts, Scotus presents a view of moral goodness that appears to be largely naturalistic. For example, in his 18th Quodlibet, Scotus writes that an agent’s act is morally good if it has an appropriate object, is performed in appropriate circumstances, is of a sort appropriate for the agent to perform, and furthermore if the agent rightly judges this to be the case and then acts on that judgment. To make these judgments about appropriateness, one needs to know only the nature of the agent, of the act, and of the power through which the agent performs the act. The moral law in its broad sense is therefore based on the natures of things and is accordingly rationally accessible to humans. On this interpretation, since human nature and human powers remain constant, the law of nature in the broad sense could change only if circumstances change, rendering appropriate what used to be inappropriate (or vice versa); in that case, however, God’s act of dispensation would seem little more than a formality.

In other texts, such as Ordinatio 1 d.44 n.6, Scotus appears to hold that what constitutes the natural law in the broad sense is simply God’s will: God wills certain propositions to be law, and they are thereby law. There is nothing self-contradictory about a system of law very different from the one we live under, for instance, a system that at least sometimes permits the killing or torture of the innocent, the telling of falsehoods, and stealing others’ property, and so no logical necessity of the sort we find in the first commandment constrains God from promulgating an alternative system of laws such as this. As Williams [1998] notes in reply to the objection that such a system is inconsistent with God’s own justice, Scotus contends that God can do whatever is not logically impossible, and whatever God wills is by that very fact right (Rep. 4 d46 q4). God’s justice, therefore, does not constrain his will to any single consistent system of laws; he may will any consistent system. It is simply God’s will that certain propositions comprise the moral law rather than others. If the laws we in fact live under benefit us, that is due to God’s graciousness, not his justice. On this interpretation, however, it is hard to see how human beings have rational access to the natural law. Williams [1997] suggests that the Biblical assertion that God writes his commandments on our hearts be interpreted to mean that God gives us moral intuitions that accord with his commands, but if that is the case, when God grants dispensations, those very intuitions (and the moral and cultural institutions built on them) would lead us far astray.

10. Action Theory and Will

Mediaeval philosophers agree that human acts have their source in the powers of will and intellect, and in articulating their detailed action theories and rich moral psychologies, these thinkers spell out the respective roles of the will and intellect. They often disagree, however, about what those roles are and, in particular, about the relative priority of these powers in the production of human acts, with intellectualists giving greater priority to the intellect and voluntarists to the will. Of course, that priority could take many forms, and so we find mediaeval philosophers investigating the extent to which the intellect influences, determines, causes, or necessitates the will’s act, and vice versa; whether our freedom or control over our acts stems more from the will, the intellect, or equally from both; and whether we resemble God more in our intellects or in our wills. While most mediaeval thinkers offer nuanced theories, the views of Aquinas, Giles of Rome, and Godfrey of Fontaines are predominately intellectualist, while those of Henry of Ghent and Peter John Olivi are predominately voluntarist. The debates between intellectualists and voluntarists are important not just because they represent disputes over the origination of human acts, but because they also represent deep disagreements on the nature of free will and rationality, on what makes humans morally responsible, and on the role of virtue in morality.

Scotus’s action theory is largely voluntarist. Although he admits that the intellect plays an important role in human action (after all, the will cannot will something that the intellect is not thinking of, nor can it will something that the intellect does not perceive as somehow good), in contrast to intellectualists such as Aquinas, Scotus denies that the intellect’s judgment about what one should pursue or avoid ever determines which alternative the will wills or, for that matter, whether it wills anything at all. Moreover, the will plays a large role in determining what the intellect thinks: Once the intellect has some object in mind, no matter how peripherally, the will can direct the intellect’s focus and regulate its thought accordingly.

Scotus means to show not just that the will is a higher power than the intellect, however. He argues for the remarkable claim that the will is unique among all created powers because it alone acts freely. Scotus’s account of the will’s freedom is complex, to say the least: In no other discussions does Scotus do more to earn his epithet “subtle.” Nevertheless, the following three key elements of his account should serve to summarize his audacious but sometimes murky discussion.

1. Some potentialities have natures that determine what operations they will or will not perform in any given set of circumstances. A 400 degree oven always operates the same way, and so unless there is some impediment, it will roast meat and dry clay, for that is the nature of heat. The way such human powers as the senses, sensory appetites, and even the intellect operate is also determined by their natures, even if they do have a greater intrinsic value than mere heat. The only power whose nature does not determine its operations is the will, which alone is a self-determining power for opposites. Among created things, the will alone transcends nature, not because it does not have a nature, but because no nature, including its own, determines its acts [Boler 1993]. The will, then, satisfies one necessary condition for freedom: It determines itself regarding opposites; that is, it determines whether it wills this object or that one, and also whether it wills this object or refrains from willing entirely.

2. The will’s capacity for self-determination is a necessary but not a sufficient condition for freedom because, as Scotus argues, even self-determined operations may be necessary. If the will’s acts are to be free, they must be contingent. To see what Scotus means, consider the following “diachronic” account of contingency. At time T1, the will has a real potentiality for willing a or b, as well as for refraining from willing. At time T2, the will determines itself to one of these alternatives, say, a. The proponent of this view admits that at T2 there is no longer a real potentiality for both opposites, but that does not matter because the real potentiality for opposites at T1 ensures the contingency of the will’s operation at T2. That strategy fails, Scotus argues, because contingency can be a feature only of something that is actual, and at T1 the will’s operation is not actual. Therefore, nothing at T1 can explain why the will’s operation at T2 is contingent. Rather, we must look for some feature of the will at T2 if we are to find an explanation of its contingency.

Scotus therefore argues that at T2 the will is really capable of opposites, even when it is determined to one of them. Like all the soul’s powers, the will is a first actuality, and so naturally prior to its operations, which are second actualities. To capture this idea of natural priority within a single instant of time, Scotus employs the device of instants of nature. In a single temporal instant T2 we find instants of nature N1 and N2. At N1 the will has a real potentiality for either a or b. At N2, the will determines itself to a. However, because all this occurs in a single instant of time T2, it is still true because of N1 that at T2 the will has a real potentiality for b, even though at that very temporal instant it is actually willing a. Therefore the will’s operation at T2 is contingent because of features true of the will at T2. Because the will’s operation is both contingent and self-determined, it is free. Finally, it is worth noting that this view does not imply the absurdity that the will can simultaneously will multiple opposites. For instance, a person cannot at the same time both intend to pursue a college degree and intend to stay out of school forever. Rather, if a person at T2 intends to pursue a college degree, there is at T2 the real potentiality for intending to stay out of school forever, but not for intending both.

3. Medieval eudaimonist philosophers contend that the will is determined to seek happiness, that is, the fulfillment of one’s nature. However, because one can at least partly determine the constituents of happiness, and because one can pursue happiness by different means, this determination of the will does not introduce any necessitation incompatible with free will and moral responsibility. Nor does eudaimonism amount to psychological egoism, because justice and its associated virtues are themselves constituents of or at the least, means to the fulfillment of one’s own nature. Eudaimonism, therefore, is no opponent of the moral life. Scotus, however, finds this line of thought problematic, and in spelling out his alternative to eudaimonism he articulates the third element in his discussion of freedom.

Drawing on Anselm’s discussion in On the Fall of the Devil, Scotus contends that in addition to the affection for the fulfillment of one’s nature, or affection for advantage, the will has a second affection, the affection for justice. Thanks to the affection for advantage, the will can seek things insofar as they benefit the willer. Thanks to the affection for justice, the will can seek things insofar as they are good in themselves. As Boler [1993] points out, the presence of the affection for justice over and above that for advantage explains two closely related human characteristics: the will’s capacity to transcend what is natural and the sort of freedom necessary for moral responsibility.

The precise sort of freedom Scotus thinks the affection for justice affords us, however, remains unclear. He might mean that our having the affection for justice in addition to the affection for advantage gives us moral freedom, that is, the freedom to determine whether and to what extent we will act justly. On the other hand, he might mean that having the affection for justice gives us metaphysical freedom, the freedom of self-determination. There is some reason to think that Scotus means both. In a famous example, Scotus asks us to conceive of a creature with an intellectual appetite that has merely one affection, the affection for advantage (because it lacks the affection for justice, this appetite does not count as a genuine will). Such a being, Scotus contends, would always seek its advantage and seek it to the maximum possible, for there would be no countervailing affection to place any restraints on its pursuit of advantage. It would therefore lack both moral freedom and metaphysical freedom as well. However, Scotus offers few details, and it is hard to see why such a creature could not have metaphysical freedom, even if it lacks moral freedom. If the will’s self-determination were limited to balancing the willer’s own advantage against the concerns of justice, then it would be easier to see Scotus’s motives for associating the affection for justice with metaphysical freedom. However, Scotus holds that it is possible, without any intellectual error or misleading passion, to will something unjust that is still less advantageous than an alternative open to the willer. In this case, the affection for justice plays no apparent role in explaining the will’s self-determination, and so it has struck some scholars that the addition of this affection explains the will’s moral freedom but not its metaphysical freedom. On the other hand, Scotus insists that the will’s two affections are not independent wills. Rather, the “addition” of the affection for justice transforms the intellectual appetite so that when one wills, the will always acts with both affections. One cannot “use” just one affection and not the other, even if one is pursuing simply one’s own advantage or simply justice. However, these observations still do not explain how the addition of the affection for justice affords the will metaphysical freedom (if in fact it does), and Scotus says little to shed any more light on the subject.

11. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Texts in Latin

  • Cuestiones Cuodlibetales (1963). In ed. Felix Alluntis, Obras del Doctor Sutil, Juan Duns Escoto. Madrid: Biblioteca de Autores Cristianos.
  • Opera Omnia (1639), ed. Luke Wadding. Lyons, 12 vols., revised and enlarged by L. Vives (1891-1895). Paris, 26 vols.
  • Opera Omnia (1950-). Ed. Scotistic Commission. Vatican City: Typis Polyglottis Vaticanis, 11 vols. prepared to date.

b. Primary Texts in English Translation

  • Duns Scotus, Metaphysician (1995). Ed. and trans. William A. Frank and Allan B. Wolter. West Lafayette: Purdue University Press.
  • Duns Scotus on the Will and Morality (1986). Ed. and trans. Allan Wolter. Washington: Catholic University of America Press.
  • John Duns Scotus: The Examined Report of the Paris Lecture (Reportatio I-A), vol. 1 (2004). Ed. and trans. Allan B. Wolter and Oleg V. Bychkov. St. Bonaventure: The Franciscan Institute.
  • John Duns Scotus: God and Creatures (1981). The Quodlibetal Questions. Trans. Allan Wolter and Felix Alluntis. Washington: Catholic University of America Press.
  • John Duns Scotus: A Treatise on God as First Principle (1983). Ed. Allan Wolter. Chicago: Franciscan Herald Press.
  • Philosophical Writings (1987). Trans. and ed. Allan Wolter. Indianapolis: Hackett.

c. Secondary Literature

  • Adams, Marilyn McCord (1976). “Ockham on Identity and Distinction,” in Franciscan Studies 36: 5-74.
  • Boler, John (1993). “Transcending the Natural: Duns Scotus on the Two Affections of the Will,” in American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 67: 109-22.
  • Boulnois, Olivier (1989). “Analogie et univocité selon Duns Scot: La double destruction,” in Les etudes philosophiques 3/4: 347-83.
  • Cross, Richard (1999). Duns Scotus. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Cross, Richard (2002). “Duns Scotus on Divine Substance and the Trinity,” in Medieval Philosophy and Theology 11:181-201.
  • Day, Sebastian (1947). Intuitive Cognition: A Key to the Significance of the Later Scholastics. St. Bonaventure: The Franciscan Institute.
  • Dumont, Stephen (1987). “The Univocal Concept of Being in the Fourteenth Century: I. John Duns Scotus and William of Alnwick,” in Medieval Studies 49: 1-75.
  • Gelber, Hester Goodenough (1974). Logic and the Trinity: A Clash of Values in Scholastic Thought, 1300-1335. Ph.D. dissertation, University of Wisconson.
  • Gracia, Jorge J.E (1984). Introduction to the Problem of Individuation in the Early Middle Ages. Washington: The Catholic University of America Press.
  • King, Peter (2003). “Scotus on Metaphysics,” Chapter 1 in Williams [2003], 15-68.
  • Pasnau, Robert (2003). “Cognition,” Chapter 9 in Williams [2003], 285-311.
  • Williams, Thomas (1997). “Reason, Morality, and Voluntarism in Duns Scotus: A Pseudo-Problem Dissolved,” in The Modern Schoolman 74: 73-94.
  • Williams, Thomas (1998). “The Unmitigated Scotus,” in Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 80: 162-81.
  • Williams, Thomas, ed. (2003). The Cambridge Companion to Duns Scotus. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Wolter, Allan (1990a). “Duns Scotus on Intuition, Memory, and Our Knowledge of Individuals,” Chapter 5 in Wolter [1990b], 98-122.
  • Wolter, Allan (1990b). The Philosophical Theology of John Duns Scotus, ed. Marilyn McCord Adams. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Wolter, Allan (2003). “The Unshredded Scotus: A Reply to Thomas Williams,” in American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 77: 315-356.

Author Information

Jeffrey Hause
Email: jph02160@creighton.edu
Creighton University
U. S. A.

Chauncey Wright (1830—1875)

Chauncey_WrightChauncey Wright, an American mathematician, philosopher, and intellectual catalyst of the Septum and the Metaphysical club at Cambridge, was a great influence on Charles Sanders Peirce, William James, Oliver Wendell Holmes, and Nicholas St. John Green. Unfortunately, Wright’s untimely death at the age of forty-five severed his growing influence on the direction of early-classical American philosophy, just when his intellectual powers were reaching their peek. Apart from some recent studies on his work, spearheaded by the eminent Wright scholar Edward H. Madden, his keen perspectives have been overlooked by both classical and contemporary American philosophers. As a thinker of the transition from early to classical American philosophy, Wright’s work captures the best of Scottish realism, English empiricism, and early science studies, especially in mathematics, physics, biology, meteorology, psychology, jurisprudence, and pedagogy, combining to establish his influence as a well-rounded, critic of system building, metaphysics, theological influence, and the imprecise use of language. His critical empiricism positioned him against any fusion of teleology in philosophy and science. He was one of the first supporters and careful readers of the work of Charles Darwin in the States, winning praise from Darwin for his clear minded approach and style, especially in his work on evolutionary psychology. Wright’s letters are the clearest testaments to his dynamic and personable style. They are exemplary of his patience and depth of cultural preparedness and prime examples of what he must have been like as a Socratic dialogue partner and “intellectual boxing master,” as C.S. Peirce stated. The collected reviews and essays by Wright demonstrate his range and precision of argument, though many reviews and scientific essays still remain uncollected. As his friend John Fiske wrote, “to have known such a man is an experience one cannot forget or outlive, and to have him pass away, leaving so scanty a record of what he had it in him to utter, is nothing less than a public calamity.”

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Work
    1. Letters
  2. The Language and Philosophy of Science
    1. Mathematics and Adequate Nomenclature
    2. Cosmology as “Cosmic Weather”
    3. Evolution as Theory of Natural Selection
  3. Theory of Knowledge
  4. History of Philosophy
  5. Pedagogy and the Philosophy of Education
  6. Recollections, Influence, and Critical Reception
  7. References and Further Readings
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Work

Chauncey Wright, mathematician, philosopher, was born at Northamptom, Massachusetts, September 20, 1830. He entered Harvard College in 1848, where he graduated twenty-seventh in a class of eighty-eight in 1852. From 1852 to 1870 Wright was employed as a computing machine for the American Ephemeris and Nautical Almanac at Cambridge, turning series of numbers into logarithms and vice versa, computing charts (ephemerids) for navigation based on the positions of the fixed stars, moon, sun and other planets. Wright taught natural philosophy at the Agassiz School for Girls from 1859 to 1860. He was elected a fellow of the American Academy of Arts and Science in 1860. In January 1870 he was offered a lecture series on psychology at Harvard College as part of the new post-graduate courses. These lectures were based on and developed from what was found in the work of the Scottish philosopher Alexander Bain (1818-1903). The lecture series, begun by Harvard’s former president Thomas Hill, had been revitalized by the then president C.W. Eliot, who also secured lectures from R.W. Emerson, W.D. Howells, F. Bôcher, C.S. Peirce, O. W. Holmes Jr., and J.Fiske. In 1874 and 1875 Wright also lectured in theoretical physics. This was the extent of Wright’s college teaching experience, and though not successful in a classroom setting, his reflections on education and pedagogy were inspiring to his friend, fellow classmate, and Dean of Harvard College, Prof. E. W. Gurney. Gurney describes how “[Wright had] some ten clever sophomores in the course; but his heavy artillery was mostly directed over their heads. They complained much to me (as Dean) of their inability to follow him; but Chauncey, with the best intentions, found it almost impossible to accommodate his pace to their short stride. His examination-papers, by the way, in this course, I remember as models of what such papers should be. Chauncey had as sound views on the subject of education, as fresh and original, and as little biased by his own peculiar training and deficiencies of sympathy, as those of anybody I ever listened to, but he has no adaptability in practice.” (Letters 212-213).

Wright’s pedagogical talents were better seen in his being a private tutor, philosophical mentor, and intellectual catalyst of both the “Cambridge Septum Club” and the “Metaphysical Club” in Cambridge. It was through the discussions and papers presented at these gatherings that Wright came to be known and respected as the “intellectual boxing master” to Charles Sanders Peirce, William James and Oliver Wendell Holmes, Jr. Also present at these gatherings were Nicholas St. John Green (1830-1876), Joseph Warner, Frank E. Abbot, and John Fiske. The scientist-philosophers of The Metaphysical Club were nearly outnumbered by members who were lawyers (Fisch 1942; Wiener 1948). Wright died in Cambridge, Massachusetts on September 12, 1875.

Wright published fifty-six articles between 1865 and 1875, the last published posthumously in 1876 in the American Naturalist. These ranged from book notices and reviews to longer technical philosophical and scientific essays. Except for his presentations to the Septum Club, and the Metaphysical Club, all lost to us except in short citations and titles mentioned in his letters, these articles are what remain of his work. He published in The Atlantic Monthly, The Mathematical Monthly, The North American Review, The Nation, Memoirs of the Academy of Arts and Sciences, Proceedings of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences, and the American Naturalist. Eighteen of his longer articles were collected and published in 1877 by his friend Charles Eliot Norton under the title Philosophical Discussions. There exists one generously detailed review, though anonymous, of this text from The Nation, dated May 17, 1877, vol. 24, n. 620, pp. 294-296. In it we find written how “[Wright’s works] form the most important contributions which now chiefly engage the attention of the students of philosophy,” and further, how “it was only Mr. Wright’s neglect to preserve his thoughts in writing that prevented him”, citing John Fiske “from taking rank among the foremost philosophers of the nineteenth century.” In a letter of recommendation that William James wrote on Peirce’s behalf to Prof. Gilman of Chicago, dated November 25, 1875, he stated, “I don’t think it extravagant praise to say that of late years there has been no intellect in Cambridge of such general powers and originality as [Peirce], unless one should except the late Chauncey Wright, and effectively, Peirce will always rank higher than Wright” (James, Correspondence, Vol. 4).

a. Letters

Chauncey Wright maintained a lively and inspiring correspondence throughout his life. It is from these letters that we may approach his conversational genius. Thanks to his friend from childhood James Bradley Thayer, these were collected and privately printed in 1878.

Wright’s letters act as a primer, glossary, and journal to connect and clarify his published philosophical perspectives, while revealing the life and dialogue of one of the great pioneers in the history of early classical American philosophy of science, metaphysics, ethics and pedagogy. Although Wright mentioned that “letter-writing [was] still odious to [him]”, just two months before his death, he added, “I think it is, but so that the good of it, the Promethean endurance and philanthropy of it, is set off on high artistic principles against its evils, the vexatious stupidities of Cadmean invention” (Letters 344). It is through these letters, crafted to a high artistic principle that a study on Chauncey Wright begins in earnest, followed by his collected works in the volume entitled Philosophical Discussions (1877). This would, in the words of his friend William James (1842-1910), allow us to see “his tireless amiability, his beautiful modesty, his affectionate nature and freedom from egotism [and] his childlike simplicity in worldly affairs” (Ryan 2000:3, p. 4).

2. The Language and Philosophy of Science

For Wright, the philosophy of science as a general theory of the universe was not a main concern. He was actually a critic of such formulations and systems, a critic of anything that began to resemble metaphysical web-spinning, as seen in the works of Herbert Spencer (1820-1903). For Wright, science, or “true science”, does not base itself on any “principle of Authority” which would include principles which are linguistically construed to substitute for dogma and superstition. Science should not be a substitute system for the lost innocence of theological speculations, nor be tainted by a teleological nature. Wright believed “true science deals with nothing but questions of facts [which] if possible, shall not be determined beforehand [nor by] how we ought to feel about the facts … nor by moral biases” (Letters 113). As part of this position he was interested and critically tuned to the issues of “motives” that generated theories. As he wrote to F.E. Abbot, “no real fate or necessity is indeed manifested anywhere in the universe, only a phenomenal regularity” (Letters 111). Many years later, in 1932, Justice Oliver W. Holmes (1841-1935) recalls this point, stating Wright “taught me when young that I must not say necessary about the universe, that we don’t know whether anything is necessary or not. So I describe myself as a bettabilitarian. I believe we can bet on the behavior of the universe in its contact with us.” Much of Wright’s position and amicable critique of the theories of science (or attempts at being “scientific”) can be seen in his letters to F.E. Abbot (1836-1903), Mrs. Lesley and Miss Grace Norton, followed by the longer more technical articles collected in Philosophical Discussions, most notably “The Philosophy of Herbert Spencer”, “Evolution by Natural Selection”, “Evolution of Self-Consciousness”, “The Conflict of Studies”, and “A Fragment on Cause and Effect”. Many of Wright’s as-of-yet uncollected review articles also contain important statements regarding his critique of, and position on the philosophy of science. The study of these articles should clarify Wright’s non-partisan view of the use of science, his accommodation of what today we would call “complexity”, his care for precision in the use of terms and definitions employed in experimental methods, and his caution against the metaphysical adaptation of science that haunted many fanciful theories of the time. Wright was cautious in focusing on what he saw as the “two uses of language – the social and the meditative, or mnemonic”. Only in their strict exchange and study would a clear language for science become possible (“Evolution of Self-Consciousness”, in Philosophical Discussions 255). For Wright, without the developed power of primary perception and attention, the meditative use of language breeds nothing but trite metaphysical glossaries, a type of false memory (projected recollections), and ultimately vague and dogmatic principles product of a faulty, unchecked use of terms and definitions. Wright sought “scientific distinctness” over “moral connotations” (Letters 112). As he wrote to Miss Grace Norton (July 29, 1874), “we suffer from a mental indigestion. We have not solved the ambiguity of words” (Letters 275). Here, as the preeminent Wright scholar E. H. Madden stated, “the concept of substance [which Wright takes to task] arises from misleading metaphors in the syntax of language [and] is not unlike modern neo-Wittgensteinian analysis” (“Wright, James, and Radical Empiricism,” The Journal of Philosophy, LI, 1954, 871). The influence in the philosophy of language is due to in part to Nicholas St. John Green, a legal scholar, and in how Green believed that “a real definition is an analysis”. This was written during Green’s involvement with the Metaphysical Club.For Wright. Language is not, nor should be used as a “lying device”, which is a “false instinct in a rational being”, a drive to return to pre-linguistic “animal oblivion” which can be dressed up in the disdain for the science and clarity of terms as seen in the works of Herbert Spencer (1820-1903), and especially in those of the Rev. James Martineau (1805-1900). Wright called this type of philosophizing “poetry under the form of science, of which Hegelianism is the most notable modern epic” (Letters 179).

A compelling reflection on the question and power of language is seen in Wright’s letter to Charles Darwin (1809-1882), dated August 29, 1872 (Letters 240-246). With a clear use of terms and a sustained use of the nature of inference, Wright believed that we could extend, check, and use our knowledge of the study of nature as tools and extensions of careful perceptions. For Wright theoretical concepts should not be used as static summaries of truth, but as ever-active non-generalized “finders”. “Finders” are the use we make of working hypotheses through testable consequences open to future experiences. “Finders” are not hardened metaphysical concepts. They are speculative tools that may arise from experience, intuitions, dreams and imagination. For Wright the language and philosophy of science must be passed through the “tools of sensible experience”, not be concerned with “ontological pedigree or a priori character of a theory”, and above all search for the driving motives of research outside fear, respect and aspiration (Philosophical Discussions 47, 49).

For such an amiable and humble individual, Wright was a very tough-minded theorist. He cautions us to realize that the positivists stage of the Theological, Metaphysical and Scientific co-exist at every level and attempt of humankind’s quest for knowledge, as well as between rival hypotheses that seek to grasp culture and nature. Wright saw the space for a true scientific attitude based upon the methods of observation and the testing of rules of investigation, not in an endless cycle of collecting hypotheses for and against said methods, rules and facts. Wright clearly followed Bacon’s lead in severing “physical science from scholastic philosophy …” (Philosophical Discussions 375). In his words, “the conscious purpose of arriving at general facts and at an adequate statement of them in language, or of bringing particular facts under explicit general ones, determines for any knowledge a scientific character” (Philosophical Discussions 205). This character must always be what Wright called “useful knowledge”, and further, “with connection in phenomena which are susceptible of demonstration by inductive observation, and independent of diversities or resemblances in their hidden nature, or of any question about their metaphysical derivation, or dependence” (Philosophical Discussions 408).

From these considerations many twentieth-century commentators, with the exception of E.H. Madden, have marked Wright as a pragmatist, or proto-pragmatist. This is not precise, since for Wright, basic empirical propositions are not open to the idea of working hypothesis at the level of matter-of-fact experience common sense beliefs, nor are long-run results safe from teleological underpinnings. Further, these basic propositions are not prone to being tested by, nor serve as, criteria of meaning. Wright avoided offering a meaning of truth, and did not generalize on the nature of thinking (Letters 325).

Wright’s prefiguring of what later came to be known in 1897 as Jamesian pragmatism and Peirce’s more trenchant “pragmaticism,” can be best understood if one relates Wright to his legal minded friends and fellow members of the Metaphysical Club. This vigor of thought and stimulus to study was carried into and from the conversations at the Metaphysical Club due to the presence of the lawyers in the group: Holmes, St. John Green, Warner and Fiske. It was especially with Nicholas St. John Green, who also taught at Harvard Law School (1870-1873), and was an instructor in philosophy, that the shared use of Alexander Bain’s and J.S. Mill’s texts would have prompted conversation on the applicability of facts, actions and rights. This direction of thought is present in Green’s article “Proximate and Remote Causes”, from the American Law Review of 1870. With Green and Holmes, Wright also shared a closer bond of the care for precision in the use of language, and in the words of Green, “a frequent cause of perplexity in law is the loose way in which legal terms are used, the same term being used to express different things” (Green, Essays and Notes on the Law of Torts and Crime, p. 146). A similar position on this precision in the use of language can be seen between Oliver Wendell Holmes and Wright and in how Holmes saw law as a study of “prediction, the prediction of the incidence of the public force through the instrumentality of the courts” (Holmes, Collected Legal Papers, 167). This was Holmes’ position from as early as 1871. Soon after that C.S. Peirce gave a talk at the Metaphysical Club, (November 1872) where he wished to pool the many conversations and ideas. Six year later, and two years after Wright’s death, Peirce published two versions of this talk as the articles, “The Fixation of Belief”, and “How to Make Our Ideas Clear.”

a. Mathematics and Adequate Nomenclature

Wright published ten articles in the field of mathematics. According to his friend and fellow mathematician Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914), Wright was a “thorough mathematician” (Ryan 2000: 188). This was indeed high praise coming from C.S. Peirce who was the son of Prof. Benjamin Peirce (1809-1880), the great American mathematician of the nineteenth century and teacher of Wright at Harvard between 1848 and 1852. Prof. Benjamin Peirce also publicly praised Wright at one of his lectures, and the modest student never appeared in class after that lecture (Letters 122). There is no doubt that Wright was influence by Prof. Peirce’s view of mathematics as the supreme science, a science that, in Peirce’s words “draws necessary conclusions.” Wright even defended Benjamin Peirce in an article left unsigned in The Nation, entitled “Mathematics in Court” (September 19, 1867).

Wright’s talent for mathematics was seen early on in his years at the High School and Select High School in Northampton, MA, and at Harvard College, where he took the elective in mathematics in his junior year. His essay on “Ancient Geometry” was mentioned in the 1852 Commencement Program. Wright continually strove for the precision of terms and form which he found so clearly present in mathematics. In a letter dated October 1864, (most likely to F.E. Abbot) he stated that “mathematician are the most exacting of purists, since, having none but perfectly adequate nomenclature, they are intolerant of, and, as one may confess, also insensible to any thought not set forth in exact form.” In Wright’s substantial review article entitled “The Conflict of Studies” (Philosophical Discussions 267-295), one may explore Wright’s perspective on the use and abuse of mathematics and its teaching. We find how Wright championed the imaginative use of memory, a training that would loosen it from the shackles of projected route memorization. Wright’s coupling of mathematics and pedagogical techniques with the recreational are telling. It is here that his influence on friends must have been most powerful, because he believed that play is a useful character or drive that overcomes the repetitive and droll “irksome exercises”. An example of this exchange exists in a letter written by C.S. Peirce to Wright dated September 2, 1865 found at the American Philosophical Society in Philadelphia, PA. Peirce’s letters explains three card tricks, fully described and then explained by mathematical calculus. This, one quickly realizes is how mathematical genius is seen at play, and how such exuberance was transformed into high-level critique and discussion. It is unfortunate that Wright’s response is lost to us.

The earliest of the mathematical works of Wright is on “The Prismoidal Formula” (The Mathematical Monthly, October, 1858). In April 1859 he published the article “The Most Thorough Uniform Distribution of Points About an Axis”, a study of the form of distributions found in the arrangement of leaves around their stem (Phyllotaxis). In October of 1871, in Memoirs of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences, Wright published a more complete study of this problem entitled “The Uses and Origin of the Arrangement of Leaves in Plants”. Posthumously, and due to the influence of Prof. Asa Gray (a former professor of his of natural history at Harvard College) Wright’s study “A Popular Explanation (for those who understand Botany) of the Mathematical Nature of Phyllotaxis” was published in the American Naturalist (June 1876). Mention of these studies, as well as a wonderful summary for those who are not very familiar with botany or mathematics, are included in a letter dated August 1, 1871 to Charles Darwin, who expressed much interest in Wright’s studies on phyllotaxis (Letters 232-233). In June of the same year, he wrote an article on “The Economy and Symmetry of the Honey-Bee’s cells” for The Mathematical Monthly where he analyses the geometrical properties of the hive-cell, which as excavation and structures share the angles of the plane of 120 degrees, or four-thirds of a right angle to any other. These aforementioned articles conclude Wright’s contributions to The Mathematical Monthly.

In April 1864, Wright reviewed Prof. Chauvenet’s text “A Manual of Spherical and Practical Astronomy” for the North American Review, which he praises as a welcomed text for students in astronomical observation and calculation, replete with a history of the science, adding also praise for Chauvenet’s work on Spherical trigonometry, the problem of Eclipses, Occultations, and the numerical method of dealing with the values of observed quantities. Wright was always conscious of how his desire for precise terms and definitions became strained when, as a mathematician, he found himself out of his element (Letters 67). He left us a remarkable statement on this danger, from a letter to Miss Grace Norton dated January 1874, which is worth quoting in full. “There is ease and ease – two kinds – in understanding [with the degree of precision which analytic habits of thought demand]. Mathematics is easy in one way, – cannot be misunderstood, except by gross carelessness; is no more vague than a boulder; is either out of, or in, the mind entirely. To make progress among a heap of boulders is, you know, far from easy, in one way; but it is easier than walking on water, or than clearing the rough ground by flight. It is easy to dream of making such a flight, and to have every thing else in our dream as rational as real things; and it is easy to be actually carried on the made ways of familiar phraseology over difficulties which we are interested in only as a picturesque under-view, but which do not tempt us to explore them with the chemist’s reagents, the mineralogist’s tests, or the geologist’s hammer” (Letters 254). In this short statement we may gauge Chauncey Wright’s philosophical position, and his main line of critique against metaphysics, theology, and fanciful system building, which strove as was previously mentioned, to “turn[ ] history into mythology, and science into mythic cosmology” (Ryan 2000:3, p. 61).

b. Cosmology as “Cosmic Weather”

Wright’s interest and writings on cosmology are an excellent example of his approach to the problems of philosophical speculation and scientific research. The tension between these areas of study is nowhere clearer than in these writings. From these meditations, Wright coined the metaphor “cosmic weather”, a most apt term to reveal the continual presence of irregularities as product of the causal complexity, mixture of law and accident in the continual production of natural and physical causes unhinged from a teleological framework and continually prone to what he called “counter-movements” – or the action and counter-action and cycles of convertible and reversible mechanical energy. For Wright, “the physical laws of nature are … the only real type of the general order in the universe … showing at every turn the ultimate play of action and counter-action in the balanced forces from which they spring” (Letters 177). These reflections are also revealed in Wright’s conceptual patience and theoretical doubts on issues seemingly complex, for instance, the nature of volitional determinations and human actions which he believed were also product of the law of causation, but more embroiled with metaphors of “good” and “evil,” which raise the level of ambiguity by the increased reliance on metaphorical characters. For Wright “it is easy to be actually carried on the made ways of familiar phraseology over difficulties which we are interested in only as a picturesque under-view, but which do not tempt us to explore them with the chemist’s reagents, the mineralogist’s tests, or the geologist’s hammer” (Letters 254). Wright uses the difficulty of predicting the weather to focus the problem that “we do not hope to predict the weather with certainty, though this is probably a much simpler problem [than those of ethics, metaphysics, and theology]” (Letters 74). For Wright, phenomena, from the simplest organism to the grander phenomena of the universe, find observational repose in the complex connections of the law of evolution (non-teleologically construed), freed from the metaphorical disputes of faith, morality, and metaphysics. For a view of Wright’s position on this, and on the principle of “counter-movements” his article “A Physical Theory of the Universe” in Philosophical Discussions, serves as a prime example. Wright’s position is further clarified in his article “The Genesis of Species”, where he writes, “the very hope of experimental philosophy, its expectation of constructing the science into a true philosophy of nature, is based on the induction, or, if you please, the a priori presumption, that physical causation is universal; that the constitution of nature is written in its actual manifestations, and needs only to be deciphered by experimental and inductive research; that it is not a latent invisible writing, to be brought out by the magic of mental anticipation or metaphysical meditation” (Philosophical Discussions 131). Wright’s use of “weather” was picked up by William James in The Will to Believe (1896), for which his friend C.A. Strong wrote on November 12, 1905, “if external happenings are weather, then internal happenings … are so too, and they maintain themselves not primarily because they are true but because they are useful” (James, Correspondence, 2003: 11).

Contained in Philosophical Discussions there are three major reflections on the issue of cosmology and a true philosophy of nature, “A Physical Theory of the Universe” (July 1864), “Speculative Dynamics” (June 1875), and “A Fragment on Cause and Effect” (1873). In Wright’s uncollected articles, one may also profit from reading “The Winds and the Weather” (The Nation, January 1858), “Ennis on the Origin of the Stars” (The Nation, March, 1867), “The Correlation and Conservation of Gravitation and Heat, and the some of the effect of these Forces on the Solar System” (North American Review, July 1867), and “The Positive Philosophy” (North American Review, January 1868).

From Wright’s earliest piece, “The Winds and the Weather” (1858), an essay-review of three texts, he states that “the study of climates is … the first step towards the solution of the problem of the weather”, yet, he adds “the weather makes the most reckless excursions from its averages…” Weather is nothing but the “perturbations of climate” where one must track the periodic and prevailing winds, a first feature of regularity noticed by Halley as trade-winds, and product of the “unequal distribution of the sun’s heat in different latitudes”. Where Wright’s forward looking view of cosmology enters his review-essay is when he notes the “disturbing [second-order] accidents”, namely, “effects of the distributions themselves upon the action of the disturbing agencies.” As part of the idea of “counter-movements”, Wright believes that “some of the outward changes of nature are regular and periodic, while others without law or method, are apparently adapted by their diversity to draw out the unlimited capacities and varieties of life … as organic nature approaches a regulated confusion, the more it tends to bring forth that perfect order, of which fragments appear in the incomplete system of actual organic life.” In a similar vein, Wright saw the vast expanse of the nebulae and stars, in the “operations of secondary causes” that works with, yet as a check on, the simplistic theory of spiritualistic cosmic evolution most always prefaced by the ever deceptive yet charming metaphor: “In the beginning….”

In “Ennis on the Origin of the Stars” (The Nation, March 1867), Wright questions the facile understanding of the “law of motion” and the misstep of writers in seeking the origin of such laws from the nebular hypothesis and the interaction of its parts; a fault, he believes, of the author’s failure to employ previous accomplishments in the history of science. This is a similar criticism he leveled against Ethan Chapin’s “The Correlation and Conservation of Gravitation and Heat” (North American Review, 1867). This reveals Wright’s belief in the “guidance of results already reached”, which would eliminate the many false moves in “retracing our steps, and remodeling our fundamental ideas”. Upon the path of results already reached, Wright would add that “no one is bound to maintain any hypotheses to the exclusion of any other, until it is proved to be true”, and as part of his principle of “counter-movements” adds that “enlightened faith … does not demand as the condition of assent the force of irresistible demonstration, nor does it deceive itself with fallacious arguments” (“The Positive Philosophy” in North American Review, January 1868). In Wright’s review of Fendler’s “The Mechanism of the Universe and its Primary Effort-exerting Powers” (The Nation, June 1875), we find a more sustained criticism of the abuse of nomenclatures when mathematical definitions are allowed to slide into speculative metaphysics. These processes, as Wright mentions in “A Fragment on Cause and Effect” (1873) are always “causes [as] a continuation of conditions, or a concurrence of things, relations and events.” Throughout his writings on cosmology, Wright maintained a healthy tension with his non-developmental, ateleological view of “counter-movements”. It was no doubt a source of conceptual worry for the builders of philosophical systems of the time, H. Spencer, J. McCosh, F. Bowen, F.E. Abbot, J. Fiske, and C.S. Peirce.

c. Evolution as Theory of Natural Selection

Of all the articles of Chauncey Wright we find the most sustained flow in his reflections on the structure of evolutionary thought, which he saw and defended as Darwin’s theory of natural selection, a theory stripped of any a priori grounds or teleological ends, and as an on-going cumulative use of experiment, observation and argument.

The essay articles that cover Wright’s reflection on evolutionary theory are “Limits of Natural Selection”, “The Genesis of Species”, “Evolution by Natural Selection”, and “Evolution of Self-Consciousness”, all of which are collected in the volume Philosophical Discussions. An earlier article entitled “Natural Theology as a Positive Science” sets the stage for understanding Wright’s elimination of all religious dogmatism from the work of science, especially the latter’s misuse of final causes, ends, and intelligent design, which amount to the “theologian’s perversion of language.” “Evolution by Natural Selection” was a critique of the English Jesuit Naturalist George Mivart (1827-1900), which Wright had sent to Darwin on June 21, 1871, and which Darwin mentions and praises in The Descent of Man, stating that “nothing can be clearer than the way in which you discuss the permanence and fixity of species” (Letters 230-231). The article “Genesis of Species” was so admired by Darwin that he took it upon himself to publish it in England. Darwin wrote, “Will you provisionally give me permission to reprint your article as a pamphlet?” In a following letter Darwin added “I have been looking over your review again; and it seems to me and others so excellent that, if I receive your permission, with a title, I will republish it, notwithstanding that I am afraid pamphlets on literary or scientific subjects never will sell in England” (Letters 231). Together with these studies, Wright also provided us with two brief book notices, one entitled, “Books Relating to the Theory of Evolution” (The Nation, February, 1875), which serves as a primer to the literature surrounding the “unsurpassable quality” of Darwin’s 1872 edition of The Origin of Species. In the words of Wright’s friend James Bradley Thayer, “Darwin was a thinker who fairly drew from [Wright] an unbounded homage; and this lasted till his death; I never heard him speak of any one with such ardor of praise” (Letters 30). Wright met Charles Darwin in London on September 5, 1872 (Letters 246-247), and exchanged many letters with Darwin, the most revealing written on August 29, 1872, September 3, 1874, and February 24, 1875 (Letters 240-246, 304-318, 331-338).

3. Theory of Knowledge

None of Wright’s essays or reviews contains a full account of his theory of knowledge (epistemology). Wright did not generalize on the nature of thinking or on cosmology as generalized evolution. One can see his theory of knowledge as weighing in on the side of an empirical view, one that must be tested towards more precise types of verification, and at all costs avoiding any metaphysical trapping of “origins”. In combining his letters and the mention of the problems of knowledge throughout his published articles, one may gain a picture of his leaning towards empirical verification, that is, where beliefs are continually tested by shared concrete experiences. A primer to Wright’s view of the problems of knowledge and its shifts from ancient to modern science is seen in the first eleven pages of his 1865 article “The Philosophy of Herbert Spencer” (Philosophical Discussions 43-96). While verification is essential to scientific method, Wright believed that “there is still room for debate as to what constitutes verification in the various departments of philosophical inquiry” (Philosophical Discussions 45). Even as an empiricist, from but not blindly wedded to, the tradition of David Hume, Wright would not settle for an undisputed base of knowledge, but was more convinced that, in shared common experience (working hypotheses), and the study of how other individual perspectives interact, one would be allowed more profitable hypotheses. On this issue of hypotheses one must carefully follow what Wright says in reference to Darwin, that is, that he was “no more a maker of hypotheses than Newton was”, and that hypotheses have “no place in experimental philosophy” (Philosophical Discussions 136). For Wright, hypotheses are “trial questions … interrogations of nature; they are scaffolding which must be taken down as they are succeeded by the tests, the verifications of observation and experiment” (Philosophical Discussions 384).

A fairly detailed view of Wright’s position on the theory of knowledge is seen in his letter to F.E. Abbot, dated Oct 28, 1867 (Letters 123-135), where Wright argues that an “impression is cognized only when brought into consciousness”, and sees consciousness as a process of accumulated, shifting, and comparative laws. In “Limits of Natural Selection” (October, 1870), Wright states, “Matter and mind co-exist. There are no scientific principles by which either can be determined to be the cause of the other.” Consciousness is co-operative memory (or trained imagination), which interacts with the senses and works its laws as “grounds of expectation” (Letters 131). This allows Wright to circumvent both the closed question of the finality of knowledge, and the specter of relativism. While he believed in grounds, he was opposed to asserting and defending them dogmatically. Two important articles that touch on this through the mention of various theories are Wright’s “The Philosophy of Herbert Spencer” and “McCosh on Tyndall” in Philosophical Discussions 43-96 and 375-384. Wright also focuses on the “form of truth” (Letters 300), where accurate statements lead us to shared and testable accounts of knowledge. Wright mentions Socrates’ attitude, that “there is no merit in any really known truth, however sacred to any one, greater than clearness and adequacy of expression” (Letters 300), for “I wonder whether you get any adequate idea from [an] inadequate sentence” (Letters 270).

Another telling letter on issue and upshots of theories of knowledge is Wright’s letter to Miss Grace Norton dated August 12, 1874. There he writes, “… the human heart is a gallery of the future, illuminated by the light of its instincts and experience reflected from pictures and images of the future and the universal. As the repository and agency of all rationally conceived ends, it is the only rational final cause to itself, however serviceable it may be incidentally to other forms of life or living beings. The uses of other forms of life to the human are not final causes, though the uses of any forms of life to the universe would properly be final, if it were true that the universe is served by them in any other way than to make it up, or be among the threads that are woven in its endless combinations – its formal rather than its final causes” (Letters 292). Along with this telling vision, Wright also warns that “to demand the submission of the intellect to the mystery of the simplest and most elementary relation of cause and effect in phenomena, or the restraint of its inquisitiveness on reaching an ultimate law of nature, is asking too much, in that it is a superfluous demand”, and adds that “explanation cannot go, and does not rationally seek to go, beyond such facts [the connection of elements in phenomena] …” (“The Evolution of Self-Consciousness” in Philosophical Discussions 247).

“The Evolution of Self-Consciousness” (April, 1873) was Wright’s most accomplished study, and one personally prompted by Darwin, and the question of the links and differences in animal instinct and human intelligence. Wright called this field of study “pyschozoology”, where he set out to show how there was “no act of self-consciousness, however elementary [that] may have realized before man’s first self-conscious act in the animal world …” (Philosophical Discussions 200). In this study Wright was clearly opposed to any mysticism in theory or religious application, seeing how it leads to vagueness, and teleological assumptions. He instead focused on the difference in degree between the stimulus and use of signs in physical and phenomenal experience, a direct application of Darwin’s stimulus-response conception. Wright saw the desire to communicate in both animal and humans; though by degree, the animal’s activity grasps the “signs” without knowledge of the sign as a sign, thus relying on “outward attention” as the main support of its common-sense nature. Humans form “reflective attention”, that is, signs that are recognized and related to what they signify, both in past use and as projected future use. This is possible when signs are recognized and manipulated through memory able to distinguish between outward and inward signs, thus as “representative imaginations of objects and their relations [kinds]” (Philosophical Discussions 208). It is through this double attentiveness that the “germ of the distinctive human form of self-consciousness” was planted (Philosophical Discussions 210).

4. History of Philosophy

Wright was by no means a historian of philosophy in the tradition of those influenced and trained in Germany, as seen years later in the Harvard professor Josiah Royce (1855-1916). However, as a catalyst for the “Cambridge Septum Club” and the “Metaphysical Club” there were ample occasions throughout the meetings to mention figures and theories that pertained to the history of philosophy. As early as 1857, C. S. Peirce recalls how he would debate philosophy almost daily with Wright, and most regularly on the work of Mill (Menand 2001, 221, 477n.42). From what we have in Wright’s letters, figures from the history of philosophy were mostly focused upon a desire to point out, question, or resolve a conceptual problem or misgiving, rather than spin a narrative of historical schools and conceptual debts. As a case in point, and to show how Wright maintained a similar position throughout the areas of intellectual interest, it is worth pointing out that Wright, using a term in David Masson’s “Recent British Philosophy”, which he reviewed in 1866, believed that “the ontological passion” is “very nearly akin to what, in the modern sense of the word, is expressed by ‘dogmatism’ [which when coupled with] his [Masson’s] scheme of classification … discovers the relations between opinions of [the] philosophers [in question]” (Philosophical Discussions 344). It is clear that Wright would see any history of philosophy as a drive to classify prone to a motive of justification. The unfolding of the history of philosophy in itself was not a necessary technique for Wright, mostly due to his non-academic employment, yet also by the nature of his wide scope of interests, of which philosophy proper was but another tool and set of problems. One possible reason for this critical position and avoidance of such “histories” is that, for him, “the mythic instinct slips into the place of chronicles at every opportunity,” so much so that he claims, “all history is written on dramatic principle” (Philosophical Discussions 70-71). Wright was not prone to enchantment over explanation, and thus not susceptible to a philosophy of history as an inexorable philosophical progression. Yet, through his letters and the Philosophical Discussions, and in uncollected publications, he did mention many figures that make up a telling configuration of philosophers. As part of the configuration we find a portion of a reading list and Wright’s favorites beginning with Emerson, who he also heard lecture on the poets at Harvard, then Sir Henry Maine’s Ancient Law, Bacon’s Novum Organum, Whewell’s History of the Inductive Science, List’s, Political Economy, Hamilton’s Lectures on Metaphysics, Lectures on Logic, and Philosophy of the Conditioned, Mill’s Logic, and Examination of Sir William Hamilton, Alexander Bain, (on which Wright based his lectures on psychology at Harvard) and of course Darwin’s Origin of Species and the Descent of Man. Among the philosophers mentioned in his Letters, not including Wright’s contemporaries, one finds, Bacon, Bain, Fichte, Hamilton, Hegel, Kant, J.S. Mill, Occam, Plato, and by far with the most mentions, Socrates. With the addition of Aristotle, Locke, and Zeno, the mentions are fairly similar in his Philosophical Discussions.

The following citation could be read as Wright’s caution in approaching the history of philosophy as a meta-narrative, and as a critique of the undertow of a Hegelian brand of mythic history. “All cosmological speculations are strictly teleological. We never can comprehend the whole of a concrete series of events. What arrests our attention in it is what constitutes the parts of an order either real or dramatic, or are determined by interests which are spontaneous in human life. Our speculations about what we have not really observed, to which we supply order and most of the facts, are necessarily determined by some principle of order in our minds. Now the most general principle which we can have is this: that the concrete series shall be an intelligible series in its entirety; thus alone can it interest and attract our thoughts and arouse rational curiosity” (“The Philosophy of Herbert Spencer” in Philosophical Discussions 71). Wright’s sharpest critique of the metaphysical pretensions of order can be seen in his essay “German Darwinism” (September 9, 1875 in Philosophical Discussions 398-405).

It is likely that the most discussed critical position of Wright on the history of philosophy would have been a study not only of concepts and methods, but also motives. “The questions of philosophy proper are human desires and fears and aspirations – human emotions – taking an intellectual form” (Philosophical Discussions 50). This reveals Wright’s more sociological and psychological interest in the conditions for the pursuit of certain theories and methods over others. “We do not”, he wrote, “inquire what course has led to successful answers in science, but what motives have prompted the pertinent questions” (Philosophical Discussions 48). Further he adds, “philosophy proper should be classed with the Religions and with the Fine Arts, and estimated rather by the dignity of its motives, and the value it directs us to, than by the value of its own attainment” (Philosophical Discussions 52). This is again clearly stated in Wright’s review-essay “Lewes’s Problems of Life and Mind” in Philosophical Discussions, pages 366-368, where he mentions issues with “method” from Plato, Aristotle, Descartes, Bacon, Leibniz, Locke and Newton. What Wright shows us is that “those who take the most active part in the philosophical discussions of their day have enlisted early in life in one or the other of two great schools [Platonic or Aristotelian], inspired predominately by one or the other of two distinct sets of philosophical motives, which we may characterize briefly as motives of defense in questioned sentiments, and motives of scientific or utilitarian inquisitiveness” (Philosophical Discussions 367).

For Wright, a history of philosophy would be an exacting engagement in discussion seeking to make the study of other minds part of the particular goods of human life, and as such would need to study how “philosophical stand-points” are but a parallax of previous doctrines (see Letters 124). Such a discursive history of philosophy (perhaps even “dialogical”) would require a “clearness and adequacy of expression” (Letters 300).

5. Pedagogy and the Philosophy of Education

Chauncey Wright’s “The Conflict of Studies” is a long review article of Isaac Todhunter’s (1820-1884) The Conflict of Studies, and Other Essays on Subjects connected with Education (1873). Todhunter was a mathematical lecturer at St. John’s College, Cambridge. The review appeared in The North American Review, July 1875, and is collected in Philosophical Discussions. Wright’s review was part of the ongoing debate on American educational reform during the mid-nineteenth century. Wright was privy to some of these changes, first as a student of Harvard College from 1848 to 1852, and then in 1870-1871 and 1874-1875 of Harvard’s early experiments in invited professional lecturers, under its then president and advocate of the Elective system, Charles W. Eliot.

Isaac Todhunter’s essay “The Conflict of Studies” notes the call for “useful knowledge” current in higher education, framing it as diffusion for and among the “humbler classes” (Todhunter 1873, 1). Todhunter, a conservative in the eyes of Wright, belongs to the line of Oxford and Cambridge masters who looked upon the growth of useful knowledge and the experimental sciences as inferior to what was taught at the ‘wealthy college or university”. Todhunter saw this difference reflected in the structures and rigor of competitive examinations, remarking that “we must not expect boys from the humbler classes to excel in the more expensive luxuries of education” (Todhunter, 1873, 21). Together with his marginalizing of the new experimental sciences, his dislike of the inclusion of any practical focus on the success or influence of mathematical study in practical life, and his disbelief in the powers of natural history or natural philosophy in raising a student’s attention to related pursuits, Todhunter stands in an opposite camp from Chauncey Wright. Wright responds to this with an insightful characterization of a letter of a young Union officer. “Command of the lower memory is doubtless improved by the mastery of some one or two subjects; the more special and narrow they are, the better, perhaps, for saving time, and even if they do not belong to what is commonly accounted essential to a liberal education. […] A young officer of the Union army in our late struggle, in a letter written on the evening before the battle in which his life was sacrificed, attributed his previous successes, and rapid promotion to responsible duties, to a six months’ study of turtles at the Zoölogical Museum of Harvard University, which was undertaken merely from the youthful instinct of mastery, or appreciation of the value of discipline, and was interrupted by the breaking out of the war and the young man’s enlistment in the service. Perhaps, however, the independence of character which determined this choice of means for discipline was the real source of the success which the youth too modestly attributed to the discipline itself” (Philosophical Discussions, 294).

The conflict of studies can be understood not only as the contrast between old curriculum and the more modern elective studies, but more profoundly as the conflict of the employment of types of memory, which Wright is clear in pointing out. “Writing and artificial memory are often, I think, in the way of a better sort of memory which holds what is worth retaining by more real ties” (Letters 201).

Wright unfolds what he considers to be aspects of a liberal education, and how a philosophy of mathematics can be re-employed towards a reform of general liberal education. The areas would be: i) the perfection of symbolism, ii) the use (applicability) of notation (symbols) to other sciences, iii) usefulness as the “objective ulterior value” of modern mathematics, and iv) where “useful knowledge” is that which is free from the mimicry of facts (cramming) and instead, focused on the moment of ‘selection” or the “utility of non-utilitarian motives.” For Wright, always cautious of his definitions, cramming is “a given amount of studious attention, either rational or merely mnemonic, given to a subject exclusively and for a short time” and this “gives the mind a different and a less persistent or valuable hold on the subject than the same amount and kind of attention spread over a longer time and interrupted by other pursuits” (Philosophical Discussions, 288). The focus on “selection” spread over a longer period of time, combines Wright’s evolutionary studies with the vision of keeping philosophy alive as the love of study, and as a “guest” not an “inmate” of the corporate spirit of the university or the “pittances of schoolmasters.”

Wright suggests a healthy dose of repetition, understood as a second mode of memory which would entail: i) the repeated acts of direct attention, (as repetition and intensity of impressions), ii) the repeated recalls or recollection, which has the variety of association, and repeated acts of voluntary recollection, or the active exercise of memory. This last mode needs “interposed intervals and diversions of attention,” which strengthen the more far-reaching constructive associations of thought (essential/rational), allowing the growth of reason. Such an understanding of the growth of reason and the re-tooling of the use of memory is directed against Todhunter’s idea that students should not question the statements of tutors, which for Wright entails shying away from appreciating evidence and learning from how experiments might also fail. Todhunter’s antiseptic vision of examinable experiments, where failure is seen as a static component, runs counter to the manifold processes involved in the love of study championed by Wright. “I venture to volunteer the advice that, in teaching philosophy, it is well to call in question and refute every thing you can, with the aid of collateral reading, in order that the young [students] may never forget that they are not studying their catechisms,–not merely studying to acquire true and settled doctrines, but mainly to strengthen their understanding, to learn to think, and doubt, and inquire with equanimity” (Letters 120).

Wright champions the “far-reaching constructive association of thought” (retentive memory), not as Todhunter believed, simple memory as exercised and practiced in the repetition of examinations as “temporary associations” (or recollection). The lower order of simple memory is not conducive to what Wright saw as the complex ends of study, that is, the “satisfaction of thought itself as a mental exercise.” What Wright grants as a testing of memory in conjunction with intuition, is raised by his example of the child’s memory of stories via contiguity and consecutiveness (retentiveness), versus a student’s memory for isolated facts in comparative mythology (recollection).

Wright suggests that the student be freed from the mere exercise of “simple memory” (or simple faith) by working with the “direct effect of illustrations … to aid the understanding and imagination,” which as part of the “ladder of the intellect” is made of the movement and counter-movements from the general to the particular, the abstract to the concrete and “to return again” (which includes the particular seen in the stages of experimental practices). “Only enough of discipline in the actual practice of experiments to enable the student to study his text-book intelligibly seems to us desirable for the purposes of a general education” (Philosophical Discussions 276).

Part of what this experimental practice entails is the use of what is recreational, that is, the fondness or love of study construed by a play-impulse. This is firmly opposed in Todhunter’s position. Instead, Wright (in Darwinian fashion) sees the aspect of the recreational (or re-associative) as what will have “habit to secure attractiveness,” where play is a useful character, or drive that overcomes the repetitive and droll “irksome exercises” (Letters 201).

The larger arena of debate, as Wright saw it, centered on the University’s duties to “mankind or to their several nations,” which entailed five related problems. The first is whether higher general university education should take on the form of a simple curriculum, or a variety of courses. The next problem must address the question of what constitutes a liberal education, which in turn will prompt the problem of the ends of a liberal education, which will lead to the fourth problem, that is, how these ends are to translate through a general education or specific studies found in lower school training. Wright’s perspective becomes clear in questioning the rather simplistic use of “ends,” geared, as he saw it, more by the “customs and institutions” within which the writers of reform (and the conservatives) are caught. Wright suggests that the problem of manifold ends requires a “scientific analysis of the experience,” which is a very sociological view. “It is quite true that the great qualities required and developed in philosophers by original research in experimental sciences are not product, or even approached, by the repetition of their experiments … Nevertheless we attribute much more value to a first-hand acquaintance with experimental processes than [Todhunter] appears to do. [Even] failures have in them an important general lesson, especially useful in correcting impressions and mental habits formed by too exclusive attention to abstract studies …” (Philosophical Discussions 274).

6. Recollections, Influence, and Critical Reception

A notice in the Hampshire Gazette, dated October 5, 1875, honoring Wright, mentions how his teacher at the Select High School from Northampton, Prof. David S. Sheldon “kindly and successfully suppressed [Wright’s rather deplorable early literary-poetic essays] and so it seems turned a very bad poet into a very great philosopher.” In Wright’s Letters J.B. Thayer, a classmate at Northampton High School shares what was reported in the notice, by yet another classmate, which describes how Prof. Sheldon “led all his pupils out into the fields and woods and taught them to observe the facts of nature, the life of plants and habits of birds, and insect, the movements of the heavenly bodies, the phenomena of the clouds …” Wright remembered this fondly, and in his Harvard College class-book of 1858 wrote of his inspired and zealous teacher and the specimens collected on these excursion through the wilds of Northampton. Though the collection has been lost, Wright retained the care and detail for these observations from Nature, especially seen in his letter to the daughter of Mr. Norton, Sara, dated September 1, 1875, eleven days before he died (Letters 353-354).

Wright was remembered with great affection by each of his friends, due to his good nature and talent for Socratic dialogue. Through the Letters this quality comes alive. A perceptive description of Wright’s person and style is found in John Fiske’s essay “Chauncey Wright” (Ryan 2000:3). Fiske writes, “his essays and review-article were pregnant with valuable suggestions, which he was wont to emphasize so slightly that their significance might easily pass unheeded; and such subtle suggestions made so large a part of his philosophical style that, if any of them chanced to be overlooked by the reader, the point and bearing of the entire argument was liable to be misapprehended.” Further he adds, “there was something almost touching in the endless patience with which he would strive in conversation to make abstruse matters clear to ordinary minds … [and] one of the most marked features of Mr. Wright’s style of thinking was his insuperable aversion to all forms of teleology … [and] more often he called himself a Lucretian [and] sharply attacked Anaxagoras for introducing creative design into the universe in order to bring coherence out of chaos. What need, he argued, to imagine a supernatural agency in order to get rid of primeval chaos, when we have no reason to believe that the primeval chaos ever had an existence save as a figment of the metaphysician!” In conclusion, Fiske wrote that “to have known such a man is an experience one cannot forget or outlive. To have had him pass away, leaving so scanty a record of what he had it in him to utter, is nothing less than a public calamity” (Ryan 2000:3, pp. 5-19).

William James also contributed a piece in The Nation upon Wright’s death, where he wrote that “Mr. Wright belonged to the precious band of genuine philosophers, and among them few can have been as completely disinterested as he. Add to this eminence his tireless amiability, his beautiful modesty, his affectionate nature and freedom from egotism, his childlike simplicity in worldly affairs, and we have the picture of a character of which his friends feel more than ever now the elevation and purity” (Ryan 2000:3, p. 4). Yet there was one mostly negative response to Wright from Borden Parker Bowne (1847-1910) written a few years after Wright’s death. It mostly defends his position against which Wright was critical, and seeking to place Wright in the camp of a crude empiricist. The article is of interest due to the effort to mention the history of philosophy with which Wright was engaged, and for which Prof. Bowne chides him for being anachronistic, lacking and narrow in historical study, and accuses him of being a mere critic, not a system-builder. If one adds to this Wright’s ateleological predisposition, his view of the belief in a God as confession of one’s speculative convictions and productions of education and experience, and in the possibility of irreligious morality, we gain part of the view of why his works were also difficult to place in the then budding neo-Hegelian religious system-builder of Classical American philosophy.

As the catalyst of the “Cambridge Septum Club” (1856, 1858, 1859), and especially for the “Metaphysical Club” (1872), Chauncey Wright was, as C.S. Peirce put it, the “intellectual boxing master”. As William James stated, Wright’s best work was “done in conversation; and in the acts and writing of the many friends he influenced, his spirit will, in one way or another, as the years roll on, be more operative than it ever was in direct production” (James in Ryan 2000: 1-2). As part of a splendid recollection of Wright as a modest, simple and well disposed friend, and as a “philosopher of the antique or Socratic type”, James’ tribute captures what Wright’s presence must have inspired. Where the perceptive and enthusiastic James overstated is in how Wright’s “acts and writing” would “be more operative than it ever was in direct production”. Apart from the few direct mentions in the works of William James in The Principles of Psychology (Preface), The Will to Believe, in Pragmatism, and once in his Letters, Wright was not made part of the emerging philosophical renaissance at Harvard.

There is a similarity in the immediate fate of Wright’s works, and those of C.S. Peirce, though the works and subsequent influence of Peirce in American philosophy was saved from oblivion thanks to the generosity of James and the care and philosophical and historical sensibility of Royce. The legacy of the works of Wright is owed to his friends J.B. Thayer, who collected his letters, and privately printed the volume in 1877, and his friend C. E. Norton, who collected his principle writings under the title Philosophical Discussions (1877). Yet, thirty-six review-articles remain in the journals within which Wright had published, from the years 1858 to 1876.

In a letter to William James, dated November 21, 1875, C.S. Peirce stated that “as to [Wright] being obscure and all that, he was as well known as a philosopher need desire. It is only when a philosopher has something very elementary to say that he seeks the great public or the great public him.” Peirce then adds, “I wish I was in Cambridge for one thing. I should like to have some talks about Wright and his ideas and see if we couldn’t get up a memorial for him. His memory deserves it for he did a great deal for every one of us [James, Peirce, Abbot]. Other of his friends, Gurney, Norton, Peter Lesley, Asa Gray etc., would be wanted to do the personal and other relations. But what I am thinking of [I don’t purpose anything] is to give some resume of his ideas and of the history of his thought” (James, The Correspondence of William James, Vol. 4. 1995: 523-524). These talks never happened.

While both Peirce and James acknowledged their personal debt to their “intellectual boxing master”, apart from a few mentions in their letters and in a few of James’ works, no directly cited conceptual links can be traced with scholarly confidence. While Charles Darwin was impressed by Wright’s work, and saw him as one of his clearest readers, the untimely death of Wright ended what could have been a more productive exchange. In Wright’s letters one finds that he possibly influenced Nicholas St. John Green in discussing the use of the terms “duty of belief”, (though reference to the author is not provided by Thayer). Wright believed that “duty of belief” means only those principles of conduct, and what follows from them, which recommend themselves to all rational beings or at least to all adult rational, human beings (Letters 342-343). One can imagine William James being present, and then adopting this critique years later for his text, The Will to Believe (1896). It was Nicholas St. John Green, as Max Fisch reports, that “urged the importance of applying Alexander Bain’s definition of belief as that upon which a man is prepared to act”, and continues, “from this definition, Peirce adds, pragmatism is scare more than a corollary” (Ryan 2000: 99, and 99n.28; 136). If C.S. Peirce was “disposed to think of [Bain] as the grandfather of pragmatism” (and either himself, or St. John Green as fathers), then perhaps, one may again refer to Chauncey Wright as pragmatism’s “uncle”, because Wright, more than anyone of his early fellow thinkers, worked under the guidance of the “instinctive attraction for living facts”, as Peirce once defined pragmatism (Ryan 2000: 136, 139).

7. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

  • Wright, Chauncey, 1850-1875. Chauncey Wright Papers, American Philosophical Society.
  • Wright, Chauncey, 1858. “The Winds and the Weather.” Atlantic Monthly Vol. 1 (January): pp. 272-279.
  • Wright, Chauncey, 1971.Philosophical Discussions, ed. Charles Eliot Norton, (Henry Holt and Co., 1877), New York: Burt Franklin.
  • Wright, Chauncey, 1971a. Letters of Chauncey Wright, ed. James Bradley Thayer, (Cambridge 1878), New York: Burt Franklin.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Anderson, Katharine, 2005. Predicting the Weather: Victorians and the Science of Meteorology, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Chambliss, J.J., 1960. “Natural Selection and Utilitarian Ethics in Chauncey Wright”, American Quarterly, 12, pp. 145-152.
  • Chambliss, J.J., 1964. “Chauncey Wright’s Enduring Naturalism”, American Quarterly, 16, pp. 628-635.
  • Clendenning, John, 1985. The Life and Thought of Josiah Royce, Wisconsin: The University of Wisconsin Press.
  • Cohen, Felix, S. 1962. American Thought: A Critical Sketch. New York: Collier Books.
  • Croce, P. J., 1998. Science and Religion in the Era of William James: Eclipse of Certainty, 1820-1880,
  • Eliot, Charles W., 1909. Education for Efficiency and The New Definition of the Cultivated Man, Boston: Houghton Mifflin Company.
  • Eliot, Charles W., 1913.The Tendency to the Concrete and Practical in Modern Education, Boston: Houghton Mifflin Company.
  • Eliot, Charles W., 1924.Late Harvest: Miscellaneous Papers Written between Eighty and Ninety, Boston: The Atlantic Monthly Press.
  • Eliot, Charles W., 1969.Educational Reform, New York: Arno Press.
  • Fisch, M.H., 1942. “Justice Holmes, the Prediction Theory of Law and Pragmatism”, The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 39, No. 4 (February 12), pp. 85-97.
  • Fiske, John, 1902. “Chauncey Wright” in Darwanism and Other Essays, Boston: Houghton, Mifflin andCompany.
  • Flower, Elizabeth, and Murphey, Murray, G., 1977, A History of Philosophy in America, Vol 2. New York: G.P. Putnam’s Sons.
  • Gardiner, John H., 1914. Harvard, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Giuffrida, Robert Jr., 1980. “Chauncey Wright and the Problem of Relations,” Transactions of the C.S. Peirce Society, Vol. 16, No. 4 (Fall): pp. 293-308.
  • Giuffrida, Robert Jr., 1988. “The Philosophical Thought of Chauncey Wright: Edward Madden’s Contribution to Wright Scholarship,” Transactions of the C.S. Peirce Society, Vol. 24, No. 1, (Winter): pp. 37-43.
  • Hawkins, Hugh, 1972. Between Harvard and America: The Educational Leadership of Charles W. Eliot, NewYork: Oxford University Press.
  • Hill, George B., 1895. Harvard College by an Oxonian, New York: Macmillan and Co.
  • Huler, Scott, 2004. Defining the Wind: The Beaufort Scale, and How a Nineteenth-Century Admiral Turned Science into Poetry, New York: Crown Publishers.
  • James. Henry, 1930. Charles W. Eliot: President of Harvard University 1869-1909, Vols. 1 and 2, Boston: Houghton Mifflin Company.
  • James, William, 1952. Principles of Psychology, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • James, William, 1975. Pragmatism, and The Meaning of Truth, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • James, William, 1992, 1995, 1999, 2000, 2003. The Correspondence of William James, Vols. 1, 4, 7, 8, 11, Edited by Ignas K. Skrupskelis and Elizabeth M. Berkeley, Charlottesville: University of Virginia Press.
  • Kuklick, Bruce, 1977. The Rise of American Philosophy: Cambridge, Massachusetts 1860-1930, New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Kuklick, Bruce, 2001. A History of Philosophy in America 1720-2000, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Lowell, A. Lawrence, 1962. At War with Academic Traditions in America, Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press.
  • Madden, Edward H., 1955. “The Cambridge Septem,” Harvard Alumni Bulletin, LVII, (January): 310-315.
  • Madden, Edward H., 1958.The Philosophical Writings of Chauncey Wright: Representative Selections, New York: The Liberal Arts Press.
  • Madden, Edward H., 1963.Chauncey Wright and the Foundations of Pragmatism, Seattle: University of Washington Press.
  • Madden, Edward H., 1972. “Chauncey Wright and the Concept of the Given,” Transactions of the C.S. Peirce Society, Vol. 8, No. 1 (Winter): 48-52.
  • Madden, Edward H., 2000.Introduction, Influence and Legacy, Vol.3 The Evolutionary Philosophy of Chauncey Wright, Frank X. Ryan, (ed.) London: Thoemmes Press.
  • Menand, Louis, 2001. The Metaphysical Club: A Story of Ideas in America, New York: Farrar, Straus and Giroux.
  • Morison, Samuel E., 1937. Three Centuries of Harvard (1636-1936), Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Perry, Ralph B., 1935. The Thought and Character of William James, Boston: Little Brown and Company.
  • Privitello, Lucio A., 2005. “Introducing the Philosophy of Education and Pedagogy of Chauncey Wright,” Transactions of the C.S. Peirce Society, Vol. 41, No. 3 (Summer): 627-649.
  • Ryan, Frank X. (ed.), 2000. The Evolutionary Philosophy of Chauncey Wright, 3 vols. London: Thoemmes Press.
  • Santayana, George, 1944. Persons and Places, New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons.
  • Schneider, Herbert W., 1946. A History of American Philosophy, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Sini, Carlo, 1972. Il Pragmatismo Americano, Bari: Editori Laterza.
  • Thelin, John, R. 2004. A History of American Higher Education, Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • Todhunter, Isaac, 1873. The Conflict of Studies and Other Essays on Subjects connected with Education, London: Macmillian and Co.
  • White, Morton, 1972. Science and Sentiment in America: Philosophical Thought from Jonathan Edwards to John Dewey, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Wiener, Philip P. 1948, “The Pragmatic Legal Philosophy of N. St. John Green (1830-76)”, Journal of the History of Ideas, Vol. 9, No. 1, pp. 70-92.

Author Information

Lucio Angelo Privitello
Email: privitel@stockton.edu
Richard Stockton
College of New Jersey
U. S. A.

Zhu Xi (Chu Hsi, 1130—1200)

Zhu_xiA preeminent scholar, classicist and a first-rate analytic and synthetic thinker, Zhu Xi (Chu Hsi) created the supreme synthesis of Song-Ming dynasty (960-1628 CE) Neo-Confucianism. Moreover, by selecting the essential classical Confucian texts–the Analects (Lunyu) of Confucius, the Book of Mencius (Mengzi, the Great Learning (Daxue) and the Doctrine of the Mean (Zhongyong)—then editing and compiling them, with commentary, as the Four Books (Sishu). In doing so, Zhu redefined the Confucian tradition and outlook. He restored its original focus on moral cultivation and realization from the more bureaucratic stance of Confucians of the preceding Han and Tang dynasty (206 BCE-905 CE) who concentrated on the Five Classics (Wujing) of classical antiquity. The Four Books became required reading for the imperial examination system from the Yuan dynasty (1280-1341) until the system was abolished near the end of the Qing dynasty (1644-1911) in 1908. In his philosophical work, Zhu fused the concepts of the principal Northern Song (960-1126 CE) thinkers, Shao Yong (1011-77), Zhou Dunyi (1017-73), Zhang Zai (Chang Tsai, 1020-77) and the brothers Cheng Yi (1033-1107) and Cheng Hao (1032-85) into a rich, grand synthesis. Zhu Xi’s thought has been the starting point for intellectual discourse and the focus of disputation for the last 800 years. His influence spread to Korea and Japan, which adopted Confucianism and the imperial examination system and were enamored of Zhu’s intellectual achievements. To study traditional Chinese philosophy, especially Confucian thought, one must engage the ideas and works of Zhu Xi.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Work
  2. Philosophy of Human Nature and Approach to Self-Cultivation
  3. Moral Cosmic Synthesis
  4. Metaphysical Synthesis
  5. Key Interpreters of Zhu Xi
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Zhu Xi was born in Youqi in Fujian province, China in 1130. A precocious child, he asked what lay beyond Heaven at age five and grasped the import of the Classic of Filiality (Xiaojing) at age eight. After losing his father, Zhu Song (1097-1143), in his youth, he was raised in the company of several eclectic scholars, including Buddhists. A prodigy, he passed the top-level jinshi exam (the “presented scholar” exam) at the young age of nineteen, drawing on Chan Buddhist notions in his answers. He continued to nurture an eclectic interest in Daoism and Buddhism until he became the student of the Neo-Confucian master Li Tong (1093-1163) in 1160. Zhu’s father had recommended that he study under Li, but Zhu delayed seeing him until age 30, when he had spiritual doubts. A master in the tradition of the Cheng brothers, Li convinced Zhu of the superiority of the Confucian Way and cultivation, to which Zhu devoted himself for the next forty years. Having passed the jinshi examination, Zhu was qualified to hold office and was assigned to several prefectural administrative posts. But Zhu was critical of central court policy on several key issues and preferred temple guardianships, which gave him leisure to read, write and teach. (This also shielded him from the cutthroat politics at court where his frankness would have been literally fatal to him.) He thus became a productive scholar who made lasting contributions to classicism, historiography, literary criticism and philosophy. He was also a master of elegant prose and poetry.

As a renowned teacher, Zhu taught the classics and Neo-Confucianism to hundreds, if not thousands, of students. His oral teachings are preserved in the Classified Dialogues of Master Zhu (Zhuzi yulei). He also published critical, annotated editions of several classics, including the Book of Change (Yijing) and the Book of Odes (Shijing), of specific Neo-Confucianism works, including the works of Zhou Dunyi, Zhang Zai and the Cheng brothers, and a more encompassing Neo-Confucian anthology, Reflections on Things at Hand (Jinsi lu). Devoted to his work, he kept busy virtually to his last breath when he was rethinking and discussing the Great Learning. Throughout life, he sought to reestablish the fundamental principles and ideals of Confucianism in order to restore the vitality of China’s cultural and political integrity as a Confucian society, since those seeking spiritual guidance and solace were inclined to favor Daoism and Buddhism over the spiritually impoverished alternative of bureaucratic Confucianism. Moreover, he thought the empire needed the spiritual élan of authentic Confucian values to meet the challenge of barbarian encroachers. His patriotism, commitment to the tradition and devotion to scholarship and education remain an inspiration to this day in East Asia and throughout the world.

2. Philosophy of Human Nature and Approach to Self-Cultivation

Zhu’s complex theory of human nature registered the possibility of evil as well as that of sagehood. On his theory, while (following Mencius, 372-289 BCE) people are fundamentally good (that is, originally sensitive and well-disposed), how one manifests this original nature will be conditioned by one’s specificqi endowment (one’s native talents and gifts), and one’s family and social environment. These together yield one’s empirical personality, intelligence and potential for cultivation and success. Zhu thought difference in individual disposition, character and aptitude for moral self-realization are due to variations inqi endowments and environments.

Preceding generations of Neo-Confucian scholars had tended not to register the complexity of human nature and the wide range of individual differences and advocated relatively straightforward approaches to self-cultivation as purifying the mind to elicit the natural responses of one’s original goodness. They tended to understand this process in itself to constitute self-realization. For example, Zhu’s teacher Li Tong had strongly advocated a form of meditation called “quiet sitting,” the efficacy of which the active young Zhu had doubted from the outset, at least for himself. Several years later, Zhu held discussions with Zhang Shi (1133-80), a follower of Hu Hong (1106-61), who had advocated “introspection in action.” Zhu initially embraced this approach, but soon found that it was not viable for himself. He found that such introspection in the heat of action could not inform or guide action. It tended to impede the flow of effective deliberate action by making one too self-conscious.

Zhu Xi’s ingenious solution was a two-pronged approach to cultivation that involved nurturing one’s feeling of reverence (jing) while investigating things to discern their defining patterns (li). Reverence, a virtue taught by Confucius (551-479 BCE) and the classics, serves to purify the mind, attune one to the promptings of the original good nature and impel one to act with appropriateness (yi). At the same time, by grasping the defining, interactive patterns that constitute the world, society, people and upright conduct, one gains the key to acting appropriately. The mind that is imbued with a feeling of reverence and comprehends these patterns will develop into a good will (zhuzai) dedicated to rectitude and appropriate conduct.

Interestingly, in later life, Zhu regarded this conception of cultivation and realization as too complicated, gradual and difficult to complete. Like Confucius, he came to accept that one must, on embarking on moral self-cultivation, establish the resolve (lizhi) to realize the Confucian virtues and become an exemplary person (junzi), a master of appropriateness in human conduct and interpersonal affairs.

3. Moral Cosmic Synthesis

In “A Treatise on Humanity” (Renshuo), Zhu Xi articulates and systematizes the classical Confucian ideal of humanity (ren) in simultaneously cosmic and human perspective. At the same time, he effectively criticizes competing accounts of “humanity” on logical, semantic and ethical grounds. Following early tradition, Zhu associates humanity with cosmic creativity. At its root, humanity is the impulse of “heaven and earth” (the cosmos) to produce things. It is manifested vividly in the cycle of seasons and the fecundity of nature. (The settled Chinese terrain and climate were moderate and productive, supporting the view that nature generally was fecund and afforded suitable conditions for human flourishing.) This impulse to produce is instilled in all of the myriad creatures, but in man it is sublimated into the virtue of “humanity” (“authoritative personhood”), which, when fully realized, involves being caring and responsible to others in due degree. Zhu Xi similarly correlates the four stages of creativity and production in the cosmos and nature — origination, growth, flourishing and firmness — that were first indicated in the Book of Change, with the four cardinal virtues enunciated by Confucius — humanity, appropriateness, ritual conduct and wisdom. He thus portrays the realized person as both a vital participant in cosmic creativity and a catalyst for the flourishing and self-realization of others. On this basis, Zhu goes on to formulate the definitive definition of ren (humanity, authoritative personhood) for the subsequent tradition: “the essential character of mind” and “the essential pattern of love.” The virtue of ren grounds the disposition of mind as commiserative and describes the core of moral self-realization as love for others (other-directed concern), appropriately manifested.

4. Metaphysical Synthesis

Zhu Xi erected a metaphysical synthesis that has been compared broadly to the systems of PlatoAristotleThomas Aquinas and Whitehead. These “Great Chain” systems are hierarchical and rooted in the distinction between form and matter. Zhu advanced Zhou Dunyi’s dynamic conception of reality as shown in the “Diagram of the Supreme Polarity” (Taiji tu), in order to conceive the Cheng brother’s concept of li (pattern, principle) and Zhang Zai’s notion of qi (cosmic vapor) as organically integrated in a holistic system. In Zhou’s treatise, Explanation of the Diagram of the Supreme Polarity (Taiji tu shuo), Zhu discerned a viable account of the formation of the world in stages from the original unformed qi, to yin and yang, the five phases — earth, wood, fire, water and metal — and on to heaven, earth and the ten thousand things. Zhu blended this conception with ideas from the Book of Change and its commentaries in setting forth a comprehensive philosophy of cosmic and human creativity, providing philosophical grounds for the received Confucian concepts of human nature and self-cultivation. Zhu’s penchant for thinking in polarities—li and qi, in particular—has continued to stir critics to regard him as a dualist who used two concepts to explain reality. For his part, any viable account of the complexity of phenomena must involve two or more facets in order to register their complexity and changes.

5. Key Interpreters of Zhu Xi

Zhu Xi was an active scholar-intellectual who held discussions and disputes with other scholars, both in correspondence and in person. He can be known by contrast with others as well as through his positive views. For example, his series of letters with Zhang Shi on the topic of self-cultivation, preserved in theCollected Writings of Master Zhu (Zhuzi wenji), provides an enlightening record of these dedicated Confucians’ quest for a well-grounded, effective approach to self-cultivation. He debated with Lu Zuqian (1134-1181) on the nature of education. Zhu focused on the Confucian Way and moral practice, while Lu argued for a broader-based humanities approach. He held a series of debates with Lu Jiuyuan (Xiangshan, 1139-93) on the nature of realization and moral conduct. Whereas Zhu advocated regimens of study, reflection, observation and practice, Lu spoke simply of reflecting on the self and clarifying the mind, considering that once the mind was clear one would know spontaneously what to do in any situation. Zhu also corresponded with the “utilitarian” Confucian scholar Chen Liang (1143-94), who disputed Zhu’s focus on individual moral realization and the received “Way” with a broader institutional approach that was more sensitive to empirical facts and conditions. Zhu generally eclipsed all of the other scholars of his day, partly because he outlived them and had so many students, but mainly because his system was so compelling. It was comprehensive yet nuanced, tightly reasoned yet accommodating of individual differences. It preserved the essential Confucian Way yet ramified it to meet the challenges of Buddhism and Daoism as spiritual teachings. Zhu’s influence rose at the end of the Southern Song dynasty and became decisive during the Yuan dynasty, which adopted his edition of the Four Books as the basis of the imperial examination system arranged by scholars trained in his approach.

While raising his standing in pedagogy, this focus on the Four Books at the expense of Zhu’s deeper, more nuanced texts and dialogues opened the door to philosophic criticism. A schematic presentation of Zhu’s cosmic theory of pattern (li) and qi lay in the background of his commentary to the Four Books, which easily opened him to charges of dualism and of reading abstract categories into the essentially practical ancient texts. Because his commentary was focused on reading and understanding the meaning, intent and cultivation message of the Four Books, critics generalized that Zhu and his method were essentially scholastic and would be myopic and stilted in facing real situations. Anyone who peruses the corpus of Zhu’s writings and dialogues, however, will find that his ontology is not a crude dualism but a holism built of mutually implicative elements that never exist in separation. Also, his reflections are always informed by knowledge of history, current events and practical observation, as his method of observation applies generally to objects (and self) and phenomena while respecting but not privileging texts. Even his comments on Confucius and Mencius often refer back to the person and the speech context, and, thus, are not entirely scholastic. His method of observation opened the door to breakthroughs beyond the “verities” of the classics, though he was careful not to play up this fact because most of his colleagues sought the truth in the texts, thinking empirical facts were distractions from the essential Heavenly-patterning (tianli) reflected more adequately in the canonical texts.

Whereas early generations of Zhu’s followers were acquainted with his broader learning, style and spirit, Confucians of the Ming and Qing dynasties knew him mostly through his edition of the Four Books, through which they targeted their criticisms of his thought. Zhu’s most eminent critic was the Ming scholar-official Wang Yangming (Wang Yang-ming, 1472-1529). In youth, Wang had admired Zhu’s learning and once even attempted to try out his approach to observation, “investigate things to discern their defining patterns.” But, after diligently “observing” bamboo for several days, Wang became ill and got no special insight into the pattern or meaning of bamboo or anything else. He therefore rejected Zhu’s approach to observation as too objective, as outward rather than inward. In the twentieth century, Qian Mu observed that Zhu would only make such observations with guiding questions in mind, around which to focus his observations; he never would have countenanced just looking, which would turn up nothing that wasn’t obvious. For example, having heard a monk claim that bean sprouts grow faster by night than by day, Zhu measured the growth of some bean plants after twelve hours of daylight and of nocturnal darkness, respectively, and found that the plants exhibited the same rate of growth day and night. (The monk’s claim had been based on Mencius’ idea that the qi was more vital at night.) For his part, Wang transformed Zhu’s theory of observation into a pragmatic theory, thereby gearing observation directly to discernment and response—knowing how to act. Thus, Wang formulated a famous slogan that “knowledge and action form a unity.” Later, he argued that knowledge is not essentially objective and factual, but rooted in an inborn moral sensitivity (liangzhi), which is elicited by clarifying the mind so that one becomes actively responsive to one’s moral impulses (liangneng). It could be said that, in his criticisms, Wang was reacting more to the scholastic attitudes fostered by the examination system than to Zhu Xi himself. Wang ultimately respected Zhu and went on to compile a text attempting to show that in later life Zhu had changed his approach in a subjective, practical way that anticipated Wang’s approach.

Scholars of the late Ming through early Qing period (mid-seventeenth to early eighteenth century), notably, Wang Fuzhi (1619-92) and Dai Zhen (Tai Chen, 1723-77), disputed Zhu on philosophical and textual grounds. Whereas Zhu had insisted on the priority of “pattern” over qi, (roughly, form over matter), Wang and Dai followed the Northern Song thinker Zhang Zai in affirming the priority of qi, viewing patterns as a posteriori evolutionary realizations of qi interactions. They thought this account dissolved the threat of any hint of dualism in cosmology, ontology and human nature. For his part, Zhu Xi would have responded that, fundamentally, “pattern” is implicated in the very make-up and possible configurations of qi; which is why the regular a posteriori patterns can emerge. “Pattern” provides for the standing orders and processes, based on the steady interactions of yin-yang, five phases, etc., that give rise to the heaven-earth world order, with its full complement of ten thousand things. The fundamental a priori patterns are thus necessary to the world order and provide the fecund context in which the a posteriori forms emerge continuously. Wang and Dai’s qi-based view could not account for existence and the world order in this sense. At the same time, Zhu did not think that “patterns” were absolutely determinative. They just set certain “possibilities of order” that are realized when the necessary qiconditions obtain. For the most part, he registered the range of randomness and free flow in qi activity that is best exemplified in the randomness of weather systems and seismic events.

As to textual grounds, Wang and Dai argued that Zhu was so enamored of his metaphysics of pattern andqi that he constantly read them into the classical texts. For example, Dai said Zhu blandly associated Confucius’ term tian (heaven) with his own notion of li (pattern; principle), quoting Analects 11:9 where Confucius, in sorrow over the death of his disciple Yan Hui, cried that “Heaven had forsaken” him. Could Zhu reasonably claim that Confucius was crying that li had forsaken him? Critics tend to find Dai’s counter-intuitive example against Zhu’s approach compelling. However, consulting Zhu’s original commentary, we find that he noted that this phrase expressed Confucius’ utmost sorrow, that he felt Yan Hui’s death as if it was his own, without mentioning “pattern.” This example does not prove Wang and Dai’s claim. It illustrates that Zhu’s commentary was nuanced and sensitive to pragmatic, situational usages despite his penchant to see his own notion of “pattern” in some of Confucius’ usages of “heaven.” Moreover, the classicist Daniel Gardner shows that Zhu’s commentary was not intended as simply a glossary with comments. It was intended as a guide to self-cultivation. Hence, Zhu sometimes recast passages in the Analects more generally to show their broader implications for self-cultivation and realization, often with the isolated countryside student in mind. Gardner shows that Zhu thus had enriched the text as a vital tool for self-cultivation, whereas the earlier commentaries of the Han and Tang dynasties had just given glosses necessary for answering examination questions.

Known in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries in the West due to the work of Jesuits in China, Zhu Xi’s thought and texts were made more widely available to western scholarship in the late nineteenth century. Early in the twentieth century, a Chinese student of John Dewey (1859-1951) at Cornell, Hu Shi (1891-1962), initially followed the empirical, textual Qing scholars in viewing Zhu as a scholastic metaphysician. But, after reading Zhu’s Dialogues in old age, Hu contended that Zhu’s method of observation was not scholastic but essentially scientific in nature. J.C. Bruce, who translated a book of Zhu’s collected writings in the 1920s, viewed Zhu’s notion of li (pattern; principle) in light of Stoic natural law. From the 1930s, the eminent historian of Chinese philosophy, Feng Youlan, interpreted li along the lines of platonic Forms making Zhu Xi appear to be an idealist and abstract thinker. In the 1950s, Carsun Chang naturalized the notion of li by aligning it with the Aristotelian “nature” or “essence,” thereby locking Zhu’s thought into a sort of descriptive metaphysics.

From the 1960s, Mou Zongsan interpreted and criticized Zhu’s ontology and ethics on Kantian grounds, saying he erected an a priori framework but then illicitly sought to derive further a priori knowledge (of patterns) by a posteriori means (observation). In the 1970s, the intellectual historian, Qian Mu examined and explained Zhu Xi’s thought directly on its own terms, without reading western concepts and logical patterns into his system. Scholars wanting to read Zhu Xi on his own terms, unmediated by western thought, turn to the five volume Zhu Xi anthology edited by Qian Mu as a rich starting point.

In 1956, Joseph Needham, a scientist, made a highly significant breakthrough by interpreting Zhu’s system in terms of a process philosophy, Whitehead’s organic naturalism. Needham successfully recast much of Zhu’s language in naturalistic rather than metaphysical terms. The cultural, moral dimension of Needham’s account has been developed by Cheng-ying Cheng and John Berthrong, while the scientific dimension has been examined by Yung Sik Kim. In the 1980s, A.C. Graham offered the most insightful and apt account of Zhu’s terminology and pattern of thought in, “What Was New in the Ch’eng-Chu Theory of Human Nature?” and other writings. Graham showed decisively that the term li refers to an embedded contextual “pattern,” rather than to any sort of abstract form or principle. He reminded us that the term li never figures in propositions or logical sequences, as would be natural for “principle.” Rather,li are always conceived as structuring, balancing, modulating, guiding phenomena, processes, reflection and human discernment and response. For example, one never finds moral syllogisms in Zhu Xi’s writings. Everything he says is about moral emotional intelligence: attunement, sensitivity, discernment, and response. Kirill Thompson has explored and extended Graham’s interpretation in a series of studies. Joseph Adler examines the roles played by the Book of Change and Zhou Dunyi in Zhu’s thought, while Thomas Wilson and Hoyt Tillman have shown the extent to which Zhu Xi re-visioned, revised and recast the Confucian Way. Wilson is interested in Zhu’s account of the Way as a sort of educational-ideological revision, and Tillman is interested in how Zhu’s account of the Way eventually snuffed out other competing versions that might have offered more practical and liberal openings in late imperial China.

In summary, the depth and range of Zhu Xi’s thought were unparalleled in the tradition. Zhu Xi studies continue to be vital, wide-ranging and contentious, drawing growing global, cross-cultural interest.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Adler, Joseph (1998). “Response and Responsibility: Chou Tun-I and Confucian Resources for Environmental Ethics” in Mary Tucker and John Berthrong ed. Confucianism and Ecology: The Interpretation of Heaven, Earth, and Humans, Cambridge: Harvard UP.
    • Expansion and application of Zhou Tunyi and Zhu Xi’s ideas to frame a cogent environmental ethic. Clear and thoughtful.
  • (1999). “Chu Hsi’s Use of the I ching” in Kidder Smith, ed., Sung Dynasty Uses of the I ching, Princeton: Princeton UP.
    • Readable and informative survey. Complements the following text.
  • (2002). “Introduction to the Classic of Change” by Chu Hsi: Translation with introduction and notes, Provo: Global Scholarly Publications.
    • Zhu Xi’s guide to understanding and using the Book of Change. Fascinating. Clear translation and commentary. A major contribution to Zhu Xi and Book of Change studies.
  • Berthrong, John H. (1994). Concerning Creativity: A Comparison of Chu Hsi, Whitehead, and Neville, Albany: SUNY Press.
    • Well-developed “process philosophy” interpretation of Zhu’s speculative thought; see Needham 1956a and 1956b.
  • Bruce, J. Percy (1923). Chu Hsi and His Masters: An Introduction to the Sung School of Chinese Philosophy, London: Probsthain.
    • Pioneering historical study.
  • Chan, Wing-tsit (1963). “The Great Synthesis in Chu Hsi,” in A Source Book In Chinese Philosophy,Princeton: Princeton UP, 605-63.
    • Translations of Zhu’s principal essays and statements on key terms, drawn primarily from Zhuzi quanshu; clear and thoroughly annotated.
  • (1966). Reflections on Things at Hand: The Neo-Confucian Anthology Compiled by Chu Hsi and Lu Tsu-ch’ien, New York: Columbia UP.
    • Zhu’s compendium of important early Neo-Confucian pronouncements; clear and well annotated.
  • (ed.) (1986). Chu Hsi and Neo-Confucianism. Honolulu: Hawaii UP.
    • Detailed studies of key issues in Zhu Xi scholarship; for the specialist.
  • (1987). Chu Hsi: Life and Thought. Hong Kong: Hong Kong UP.
    • (General essays; clear and accessible.)
  • (1989). Chu Hsi: New Studies. Honolulu: Hawaii UP.
    • Detailed studies of key issues in Zhu Xi scholarship; for the specialist.
  • Chang, Carsun (1957). “Chu Hsi, The Great Synthesizer,” in The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought, vol. 1, New York: Bookman, 243-332.
    • Aristotelian account of Zhu’s philosophy, viewed in contrast to Zhu’s rivals’ opinions. Attempted corrective of Feng’s platonic reading of Zhu Xi; see next entry.
  • Feng, Youlan (1953). “Chu Hsi,” trans. D. Bodde in A History of Chinese Philosophy, 2 vols., Princeton: Princeton UP, vol. 2, 533-71.
    • Highly influential pioneering platonic account of Zhu’s thought in English; technical but clearly presented.
  • Gardner, Daniel (1986). Chu Hsi and Ta-hsueh: Neo-Confucian Reflection on the Confucian Canon,Cambridge: Harvard UP.
    • Translation of Zhu’s commentary on the “Great Learning,” a major classical cultivation text; with excellent commentary and supporting essays.)
  • (1990). Learning to Be a Sage: Selections from the Conversations of Master Chu, Arranged Topically,Berkeley: California UP.
    • (Zhu’s teachings on learning and study as a method of self-cultivation; very clear and accessible.
  • (2003). Zhu Xi’s Reading of the Analects: Canon, Commentary and the Classical Tradition, New York: Columbia UP.
    • Insightful, corrective study of Zhu’s mission and accomplishment in writing this commentary.
  • Graham, A.C. (1986) “What was New in the Ch’eng-Chu Theory of Human Nature?” in Wing-tsit Chan (ed) Chu Hsi and Neo-Confucianism, Honolulu: Hawaii UP, 138-157.
    • Ground-breaking study; corrective reinterpretation of Zhu’s main concepts and ethical thought.
  • Kim, Yung Sik (2000). The Natural Philosophy of Chu Hsi 1130-1200, Philadelphia: American Philosophical Society.
    • Clear and multifaceted study of Zhu’s proto-scientific efforts and achievements; see Thompson 2002b for critical analysis.
  • Lovejoy, Arthur O. (1936 & 1964) The Great Chain of Being: A Study of the History of an Idea,Cambridge: Harvard UP.
    • An account of hierarchical systems in the West, to which Zhu’s system is a distant cousin; see Thompson 1994 for discussion.
  • Needham, Joseph (1956a). “The Neo-Confucians,” in Science and Civilisation in China, vol. 2,History of Scientific Thought, Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 455-95.
    • Highly influential organismic account of Zhu’s thought; lucid and fascinating.
  • Needham, Joseph (1956b). “Chu Hsi, Leibniz, and the Philosophy of Organism,” in the preceding book, 496-505.
    • Highly influential organismic account of Zhu’s thought; lucid and fascinating.
  • Schirokauer, Conrad (1962). “Chu Hsi’s Political Career: A Study in Ambivalence,” in A. Wright and D. Twichert (eds) Confucian Personalities, Stanford: Stanford UP, 162-88.
    • Detailed but engaging account.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (1988) “Li and Yi as Immanent: Chu Hsi’s Thought in Practical Perspective,”Philosophy East and West 38 (1): 30-46.
    • Corrective account of Zhu’s ontology and ethical theory; lucid and informative.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (1991). “How to Rejuvenate Ethics: Suggestions from Chu Hsi,” Philosophy East and West (41): 493-513.
    • Examination of how Zhu Xi’s thought could rejuvenate contemporary western ethics.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (1994). “Hierarchy of Immanence: Chu Hsi’s Pattern of Thought,” Humanitas Taiwanica (Wen-shih-che hsueh-pao, National Taiwan University (42): 1-30.
    • Examines parallels and differences between Zhu’s philosophy and Great Chain philosophies of the western tradition, in order to reveal strengths and special features of Zhu’s system.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (2002a). “Ethical Insights from Chu Hsi,” in M. Barnhart, ed., Varieties of Ethical Reflection, New York and London: Lexington Books.
    • Presentation of Zhu’s method of ethical thinking, with applications to some difficult issues in Western ethics.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (2002b). “Review article of “Yung Sik Kim, The Natural Philosophy of Chu Hsi 1130-1200,” China Review International (9): 165-80.
    • Critical examination of Kim’s study of Zhu’s proto-scientific thought.
  • Thompson, Kirill O. (2007). “The Archery of Wisdom in the Stream of Life: Zhu Xi’s Reflections on the Four Books,Philosophy East and West, vol. 56, no. 3 (July).
    • Study of Confucius and Mencius’ fascinating notion of wisdom in the light of Zhu Xi’s salient reflections.
  • Tillman, Hoyt (1992). Confucian Discourse and Chu Hsi’s Ascendancy, Honolulu: Hawaii UP.
    • Detailed historical study that situates Zhu in the context of the intellectual issues and debates of the day.
  • Wilson, Thomas A. (1995) Genealogy of the Way: the construction and uses of the Confucian tradition in late imperial China, Stanford: Stanford University Publications.
    • New approach that sees politics and ideology in the competing accounts of the Confucian Way.
  • Wittenborn, Allen (1991). Further Reflections at Hand: A Reader, New York: University Press of America.
    • Useful compendium of Zhu’s philosophic pronouncements; clear translation with detailed commentary.
  • Zhu Xi (1130-1200). Zhuzi yulei (Classified Dialogues of Master Zhu), trans. J.P. Bruce, The Philosophy of Human Nature, London: Probstain, 1922.
    • Compendium of Zhu’s moral psychology drawn from Zhuzi quanshu (“Complete” Works of Master Zhu), abstruse. Other translated selections can be found in Chan 1963, 1966; Gardner 1986, 1990, 2003; Wittenborn 1991.

Author Information

Kirill O. Thompson
Email: ktviking@ntu.edu.tw
National Taiwan University
Taiwan

Alfred North Whitehead (1861—1947)

WhiteheadAlfred North Whitehead was a notable mathematician, logician, educator and philosopher. The staggering complexity of Whitehead’s thought, coupled with the extraordinary literary quality of his writing, have conspired to make Whitehead (in an oft-repeated saying) one of the most-quoted but least-read philosophers in the Western canon. While he is widely recognized for his collaborative work with Bertrand Russell on the Principia Mathematica, he also made highly innovative contributions to philosophy, especially in the area of process metaphysics. Whitehead was an Englishman by birth and a mathematician by formal education. He was highly regarded by his students as a teacher and noted as a conscientious and hard-working administrator. The volume of his mathematical publication was never great, and much of his work has been eclipsed by more contemporary developments in the fields in which he specialized. Yet many of his works continue to stand out as examples of expository clarity without ever sacrificing logical rigor, while his theory of “extensive abstraction” is considered to be foundational in contemporary field of formal spatial relations known as “mereotopology.”

Whitehead’s decades-long focus on the logical and algebraic issues of space and geometry which led to his work on extension, became an integral part of an explosion of profoundly original philosophical work He began publishing even as his career as an academic mathematician was reaching a close. The first wave of these philosophical works included his Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge, The Concept of Nature, and The Principle of Relativity, published between 1919 and 1922. These books address the philosophies of science and nature, and include an important critique of the problem of measurement raised by Albert Einstein’s general theory of relativity. They also present an alternative theory of space and gravity. Whitehead built his system around an event-based ontology that interpreted time as essentially extensive rather than point-like.

Facing mandatory retirement in England, Whitehead accepted a position at Harvard in 1924, where he continued his philosophical output. His Science and the Modern World offers a careful critique of orthodox scientific materialism and presents his first worked-out version of the related fallacies of “misplaced concreteness” and “simple location.” The first fallacy is the error of treating an abstraction as though it were concretely real. The second is the error of assuming that anything that is real must have a simple spatial location. But the pinnacle of Whitehead’s metaphysical work came with his monumental Process and Reality in 1929 and his Adventures of Ideas in 1933. The first of these books gives a comprehensive and multi-layered categoreal system of internal and external relations that analyzes the logic of becoming an extension within the context of a solution to the problem of the one and the many, while also providing a ground for his philosophy of nature. The second is an outline of a philosophy of history and culture within the framework of his metaphysical scheme.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Thought and Writings
    1. Major Thematic Structures
    2. Mathematical Works
    3. Writings on Education
    4. Philosophy of Nature
    5. Metaphysical Works
  3. Influence and Legacy
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Alfred North Whitehead was born on February 15th, 1861 at Ramsgate in Kent, England, to Alfred and Maria Whitehead. Thought by his parents to be too delicate for the rough and tumble world of the English public school system, young Alfred was initially tutored at home. Ironically, when he was finally placed in public school, Whitehead became both head boy of his house and captain of his school’s rugby team. Whitehead always looked upon his days as a boy as a rather idyllic time. The education he received at home was always congenial to his natural habit of thinking, and he was able to spend long periods of time walking about in English country settings that were rich with history.

While Whitehead always enjoyed the classics, his true strength was with mathematics. Because of both its quality, and the unique opportunity to take the entrance examinations early, Alfred tested for Trinity College, Cambridge, in 1879, a year before he would otherwise have been allowed to enter. Whitehead’s focus was in mathematics, as were those of about half the hopefuls that were taking the competitive exams that year. While not in the very top tier, Whitehead’s exam scores were nevertheless good enough to gain him entrance into Trinity for the school year beginning in 1880, along with a £50 scholarship. While the money was certainly important, the scholarship itself qualified Whitehead for further rewards and considerations, and set him on the path to eventually being elected a Fellow of Trinity.

This happened in 1884, with the completion of his undergraduate work and his high standing in the finals examinations in mathematics for that year. Whitehead’s early career was focused on teaching, and it is known that he taught at Trinity during every term from 1884 to 1910. He traveled to Germany during an off-season at Cambridge (probably 1885), in part to learn more of the work of such German mathematicians as Felix Klein. Whitehead was also an ongoing member of various intellectual groups at Cambridge during this period. But he published nothing of note, and while he was universally praised as a teacher, the youthful Alfred displayed little promise as a researcher.

In 1891, when he was thirty years of age, Whitehead married Evelyn Wade. Evelyn was in every respect the perfect wife and partner for Alfred. While not conventionally intellectual, Evelyn was still an extremely bright woman, fiercely protective of Alfred and his work, and a true home-maker in the finest sense of the term. Although Evelyn herself was never fully accepted into the social structures of Cambridge society, she always ensured that Alfred lived in a comfortable, tastefully appointed home, and saw to it that he had the space and opportunity to entertain fellow scholars and other Cambrians in a fashion that always reflected well upon the mathematician.

It is also in this period that Whitehead began work on his first major publication, his Treatise on Universal Algebra. Perhaps with his new status as a family man, Whitehead felt the need to better establish himself as a Cambridge scholar. The book would ultimately be of minimal influence in the mathematical community. Indeed, the mathematical discipline that goes by that name shares only its name with Whitehead’s work, and is otherwise a very different area of inquiry. Still, the book established Whitehead’s reputation as a scholar of note, and was the basis for his 1903 election as a Fellow of the Royal Society.

It was after the publication of this work that Whitehead began the lengthy collaboration with his student, and ultimately Trinity Fellow, Bertrand Russell, on that monumental work that would become the Principia Mathematica. However, the final stages of this collaboration would not occur within the precincts of Cambridge. By 1910, Whitehead had been at Trinity College for thirty years, and he felt his creativity was being stifled. But it was also in this year that Whitehead’s friend and colleague Andrew Forsyth’s long-time affair with a married woman turned into a public indiscretion. It was expected that Forsyth would lose his Cambridge professorship, but the school took the extra step of withdrawing his Trinity Fellowship as well. Publicly in protest of this extravagant action, Whitehead resigned his own professorship (though not his Fellowship) as well. Privately, it was the excuse he needed to shake up his own life.

At the age of 49 and lacking even the promise of a job, Whitehead moved his family to London, where he was unemployed for the academic year of 1910 – 11. It was Evelyn who borrowed or bullied the money from their acquaintances that kept the family afloat during that time. Alfred finally secured a lectureship at University College, but the position offered no chance of growth or advancement for him. Finally in 1914, the Imperial College of Science and Technology in London appointed him as a professor of applied Mathematics.

It was here that Whitehead’s initial burst of philosophical creativity occurred. His decades of research into logic and spatial reasoning expressed itself in a series of three profoundly original books on the subjects of science, nature, and Einstein’s theory of relativity. At the same time, Whitehead maintained his teaching load while also assuming an increasing number of significant administrative duties. He was universally praised for his skill in all three of these general activities. However, by 1921 Whitehead was sixty years old and facing mandatory retirement within the English academic system. He would only be permitted to work until his sixty-fifth birthday, and then only with an annual dispensation from Imperial College. So it was that in 1924, Whitehead accepted an appointment as a professor of philosophy at Harvard University.

While Whitehead’s work at Imperial College is impressive, the explosion of works that came during his Harvard years is absolutely astounding. These publications include Science and the Modern World, Process and Reality, and Adventures of Ideas.

Whitehead continued to teach at Harvard until his retirement in 1937. He had been elected to the British Academy in 1931, and awarded the Order of Merit in 1945. He died peacefully on December 30th, 1947. Per the explicit instructions in his will, Evelyn Whitehead burned all of his unpublished papers. This action has been the source of boundless regret for Whitehead scholars, but it was Whitehead’s belief that evaluations of his thought should be based exclusively on his published work.

2. Thought and Writings

a. Major Thematic Structures

The thematic and historical analyses of Whitehead’s work largely coincide. However, these two approaches naturally lend themselves to slightly different emphases, and there are important historical overlaps of the dominating themes of his thought. So it is worthwhile to view these themes ahistorically prior to showing their temporal development.

The first of these thematic structures might reasonably be called “the problem of space.” The confluence of several trends in mathematical research set this problem at the very forefront of Whitehead’s own inquiries. James Clerk Maxwell’s Treatise on electromagnetism had been published in 1873, and Maxwell himself taught at Cambridge from 1871 until his death in 1879. The topic was a major subject of interest at Cambridge, and Whitehead wrote his Trinity Fellowship dissertation on Maxwell’s theory. During the same period, William Clifford in England, and Felix Klein and Wilhelm Killing in Germany were advancing the study of spaces of constant curvature. Whitehead was well aware of their work, as well as that of Hermann Grassmann, whose ideas would later become of central importance in tensor analysis.

The second major trend of Whitehead’s thought can be usefully abbreviated as “the problem of history,” although a more accurate descriptive phrase would be “the problem of the accretion of value.” Of the two themes, this one can be the more difficult to discern within Whitehead’s corpus, partly because it is often implicit and does not lend itself to formalized analysis. In its more obvious forms, this theme first appears in Whitehead’s writings on education. However, even in his earliest works, Whitehead’s concern with the function of symbolism as an instrument in the growth of knowledge shows a concern for the accretion of value. Nevertheless, it is primarily with his later philosophical work that this topic emerges as a central element and primary focus of his thought.

b. The Early Mathematical Works

Whitehead’s first major publication was his A Treatise on Universal Algebra with Applications (“UA,” 1898.) (Whenever appropriate, common abbreviations will be given, along with the year of publication, for Whitehead’s major works.) Originally intended as a two-volume work, the second volume never appeared as Whitehead’s thinking on the subject continued to evolve, and as the plans for Principia Mathematica eventually came to incorporate many of the objectives of this volume. Despite the “algebra” in the title, the work is primarily on the foundations of geometry and formal spatial relations. UA offers little in the way of original research by Whitehead. Rather, the work is primarily expository in character, drawing together a number of previously divergent and scattered themes of mathematical investigation into the nature of spatial relations and their underlying logic, and presenting them in a systematic form.

While the book helped establish Whitehead’s reputation as a scholar and was the basis of his election as a Fellow of the Royal Society, UA had little direct impact on mathematical research either then or later. Part of the problem was the timing and approach of Whitehead’s method. For while he was very explicit about the need for the rigorous development of symbolic logic, Whitehead’s logic was “algebraic” in character. That is to say, Whitehead’s focus was on relational systems of order and structure preserving transformations. In contrast, the approaches of Giuseppe Peano and Gottlob Frege, with their emphasis on proof and semantic relations, soon became the focus of mathematical attention. While these techniques were soon to become of central importance for Whitehead’s own work, the centrality of algebraic methods to Whitehead’s thinking is always in evidence, especially in his philosophy of nature and metaphysics. The emphasis on structural relations in these works is a key component to understanding his arguments.

In addition, UA itself was one in a rising chorus of voices that had begun to take the work of Hermann Grassmann seriously. Grassmann algebras would come to play a vital role in tensor analysis and general relativity. Finally, the opening discussion of UA regarding the importance and uses of formal symbolism remains of philosophical interest, both in its own right and as an important element in Whitehead’s later thought.

Other early works by Whitehead include his two short books, the Axioms of Projective Geometry (1906) and the Axioms of Descriptive Geometry (1907). These works take a much more explicitly logical approach to their subject matter, as opposed to the algebraic techniques of Whitehead’s first book. However, it remains the case that these two works are not about presenting cutting edge research so much as they are about the clear and systematic development of existing materials. As suggested by their titles, the approach is axiomatic, with the axioms chosen for their illustrative and intuitive value, rather than their strictly logical parsimony. As such, these books continue to serve as clear and concise introductions to their subject matters.

Even as he was writing the two Axioms books, Whitehead was well into the collaboration with Bertrand Russell that would lead to the three volumes of the Principia Mathematica. Although most of the Principia was written by Russell, the work itself was a truly collaborative endeavor, as is demonstrated by the extant correspondence between the two. The intention of the Principia was to deduce the whole of arithmetic from absolutely fundamental logical principles. But Whitehead’s role in the project, besides working with Russell on the vast array of details in the first three volumes, was to be the principal author of a fourth volume whose focus would be the logical foundations of geometry. Thus, what Whitehead had originally intended to be the second volume of UA had transformed into the fourth volume of the Principia Mathematica, and like that earlier planned volume, the fourth part of Principia Mathematica never appeared. It would not be until Whitehead’s published work on the theory of extension, work that never appeared independently but always as a part of a larger philosophical enterprise, that his research into the foundations of geometry would finally pay off.

c. Writings on Education

By the time the Principia was published, Whitehead had left his teaching position at Trinity, and eventually secured a lectureship at London’s University College. It was in these London years that Whitehead published a number of essays and addresses on the theory of education. But it would be a mistake to suppose that his concern with education began with the more teaching-oriented (as opposed to research-oriented) positions he occupied after departing Cambridge. Whitehead had long been noted as an exceptional lecturer by his students at Cambridge. He also took on less popular teaching duties, such as teaching at the non-degree conferring women’s institutions associated with Cambridge of Girton and Newham colleges.

Moreover, the concern for the conveyance of ideas is evident from the earliest of Whitehead’s writings. The very opening pages of UA are devoted to a discussion of the reasons and economies of well-chosen symbols as aids to the advancement of thought. Or again, the intention underlying the two Axioms books was not so much the advancement of research as the communication of achieved developments in mathematics. Whitehead’s book, An Introduction to Mathematics (1911), published in the midst of the effort to get the Principia out, had no research agenda per se. This book was again entirely devoted toward introducing students to the character of mathematical thought, to the methods of abstraction, the nature of variables and functions, and to offer some sense of the power and generality of these formalisms.

Whitehead’s essays that specifically address education often do so with the explicit desire to revise the teaching of mathematics in England. But they also argue, both explicitly and implicitly, for a balance of liberal education devoted to the opening of the mind, with technical education intended to facilitate the vocational aptitudes of the student. Education for Whitehead was never just the mere memorization of ancient stories and empty abstractions, any more than it was just the technical training of the working class. It always entailed the growth of the student as a fully functioning human being. In this respect, as well as others, Whitehead’s arguments compare favorably with those of John Dewey.

Whitehead never systematized his educational thought the way Dewey did, so these ideas must be gleaned from his various essays and looked for as an implicit foundation to such larger works as his Adventures of Ideas (see below). Many of Whitehead’s essays on education were collected together in The Aims of Education, published in 1929, as well as his Essays in Science and Philosophy, published in 1948.

d. The Philosophy of Nature

Whitehead’s interest in the problem of space was, at least from his days as a graduate student at Cambridge, more than just an interest in the purely formal or mathematical aspects of geometry. It is to be recalled that his dissertation was on Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism, which was a major development in the ideas that led to Einstein’s theories of special and general relativity. The famous Michelson-Morely experiment to measure the so-called “Ether drift” was a response to Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism. Einstein himself offers only a generic nod toward the experiments regarding space and light in his 1905 paper on special relativity. The problem Einstein specifically cites in that paper is the lack of symmetry then to be found in theories of space and the behavior of electromagnetic phenomena. By 1910, when the first volume of the Principia Mathematica was being published, Hermann Minkowski had reorganized the mathematics of Einstein’s special relativity into a four-dimensional non-Euclidean manifold. By 1914, two years before the publication of Einstein’s paper on general relativity, theoretical developments had advanced to the extent that an expedition to the Crimea was planned to observe the predicted bending of stellar light around the sun during an eclipse. This expedition was cancelled with the eruption of the First World War.

These developments helped conspire to prevent Whitehead’s planned fourth volume of the Principia from ever appearing. A few papers appeared during the war years, in which a relational theory of space begins to emerge. What is perhaps most notable about these papers is that they are no longer specifically mathematical in nature, but are explicitly philosophical. Finally, in 1919 and 1920, Whitehead’s thought appeared in print with the publications of two books, An Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge (“PNK,” 1919) and The Concept of Nature (“CN,” 1920).

While PNK is much more formally technical than CN, both books share a common and radical view of nature and science that rejects the identification of nature with the mathematical tools used to characterize its relational structures. Nature for Whitehead is that which is experienced through the senses. For this reason, Whitehead argues that there are no such things as “points” of either time or space. An infinitesimal point is a high abstraction with no experiential reality, while time and space are irreducibly extensional in character.

To account for the effectiveness of mathematical abstractions in their application to natural knowledge, Whitehead introduced his theory of “extensive abstraction.” By using the logical and topological structures of concentric part-whole relations, Whitehead argued that abstract entities such as geometric points could be derived from the concrete, extensive relations of space and time. These abstract entities, in their turn, could be shown to be significant of the nature they had been abstractively derived from. Moreover, since these abstract entities were formally easier to use, their significance of nature could be retained through their various deductive relations, thereby giving evidence for further natural significances by this detour through purely abstract relations.

Whitehead also rejected “objects” as abstractions, and argued that the fundamental realities of both experience and nature are events. Events are themselves irreducibly extended entities, where the temporal / durational extension is primary. “Objects” are the idealized significances that retain a stable meaning through an event or family of events.

It is important to note here that Whitehead is arguing for a kind of empiricism. But, as Victor Lowe has noted, this empiricism is more akin to the ideas of William James than it is to the logical positivism of Whitehead’s day. In other words, Whitehead is arguing for a kind of Jamesian “radical empiricism,” in which sense-data are abstractions, and the basic deliverances of raw experience include such things as relations and complex events.

These ideas were further developed with the publication of Whitehead’s The Principles of Relativity with Applications to Natural Science (“R,” 1922). Here Whitehead proposed an alternative physical theory of space and gravity to Einstein’s general relativity. Whitehead’s theory has commonly been classified as “quasi-linear” in the physics literature, when it should properly be describes as “bimetric.” Einstein’s theory collapses the physical and the spatial into a single metric, so that gravity and space are essentially identified. Whitehead pointed out that this then loses the logical relations necessary to make meaningful cosmological measurements. In order to make meaningful measurements of space, we must know the geometry of that space so that the congruence relations of our measurement instruments can be projected through that space while retaining their significance. Since Einstein’s theory loses the distinction between the physical and the geometrical, the only way we can know the geometry of the space we are trying to measure is if we first know the distributions of matter and energy throughout the cosmos that affect that geometry. But we can only know these distributions if we can first make accurate measurements of space. Thus, as Whitehead argued, we are left in the position of first having to know everything before we can know anything.

Whitehead argued that the solution to this problem was to separate the necessary relations of geometry from the contingent relations of physics, so that one’s theory of space and gravity is “bimetric,” or is built from the two metrics of geometry and physics. Unfortunately, Whitehead never used the term “bimetric,” and his theory has often been misinterpreted. Questions of the viability of Whitehead’s specific theory have needlessly distracted both philosophers and physicists from the real issue of the class of theories of space and gravity that Whitehead was arguing for. Numerous viable bimetric alternatives to Einstein’s theory of relativity are currently known in the physics literature. But because Whitehead’s theory has been misclassified and its central arguments poorly understood, the connections between Whitehead’s philosophical arguments and these physical theories have largely gone unnoticed.

e. The Metaphysical Works

The problems Whitehead had engaged with his triad of works on the philosophy of nature and science required a complete re-evaluation of the assumptions of modern science. To this end, Whitehead published Science in the Modern World (“SMW,” 1925). This work had both a critical and a constructive aspect, although the critical themes occupied most of Whitehead’s attention. Central to those critical themes was Whitehead’s challenge to dogmatic scientific materialism developed through an analysis of the historical developments and contingencies of that belief. In addition, he continued with the themes of his earlier triad, arguing that objects in general, and matter in particular, are abstractions. What are most real are events and their mutual involvements in relational structures.

Already in PNK, Whitehead had characterized electromagnetic phenomena by saying that while such phenomena could be related to specific vector quantities at each specific point of space, they express “at all points one definite physical fact” (PNK, 29). Physical facts such as electromagnetic phenomena are single, relational wholes, but they are spread out across the cosmos. In SMW Whitehead called the failure to appreciate this holism and the relational connectedness of reality, “the fallacy of simple location.” According to Whitehead, much of contemporary science, driven as it was by the dogma of materialism, was committed to the fallacy that only such things as could be localized at a mathematically simple “point” of space and time were genuinely real. Relations and connections were, in this dogmatic view, secondary to and parasitic upon such simply located entities. Whitehead saw this as reversing the facts of nature and experience, and devoted considerable space in SMW to criticizing it.

A second and related fallacy of contemporary science was what Whitehead identified in SMW as, “the fallacy of misplaced concreteness.” While misplaced concreteness could include treating entities with a simple location as more real than those of a field of relations, it also went beyond this. Misplaced concreteness included treating “points” of space or time as more real than the extensional relations that are the genuine deliverances of experience. Thus, this fallacy resulted in treating abstractions as though they were concretely real. In Whitehead’s view, all of contemporary physics was infected by this fallacy, and the resultant philosophy of nature had reversed the roles of the concrete and the abstract.

The critical aspects of SMW were ideas that Whitehead had already expressed (in different forms) in his previous publications, only now with more refined clarity and persuasiveness. On the other hand, the constructive arguments in SMW are astonishing in their scope and subtlety, and are the first presentation of his mature metaphysical thinking. For example, the word “prehension,” which Whitehead defines as “uncognitive apprehension” (SMW 69) makes its first systematic appearance in Whitehead’s writings as he refines and develops the kinds and layers of relational connections between people and the surrounding world. As the “uncognitive” in the above is intended to show, these relations are not always or exclusively knowledge based, yet they are a form of “grasping” of aspects of the world. Our connection to the world begins with a “pre-epistemic” prehension of it, from which the process of abstraction is able to distill valid knowledge of the world. But that knowledge is abstract and only significant of the world; it does not stand in any simple one-to-one relation with the world. In particular, this pre-epistemic grasp of the world is the source of our quasi- a priori knowledge of space which enables us to know of those uniformities that make cosmological measurements, and the general conduct of science, possible.

SMW goes far beyond the purely epistemic program of Whitehead’s philosophy of nature. The final three chapters, entitled “God,” “Religion and Science,” and “Requisites for Social Progress,” clearly announce the explicit emergence of the second major thematic strand of Whitehead’s thought, the “problem of history” or “the accretion of value.” Moreover, these topics are engaged with the same thoroughly relational approach that Whitehead previously used with nature and science.

Despite the foreshadowing of these last chapters of SMW, Whitehead’s next book may well have come as a surprise to his academic colleagues. Whitehead’s brief Religion in the Making (“RM,” 1926) tackles no part of his earlier thematic problem of space, but instead focuses entirely on the second thematic of history and value. Whitehead defines religion as “what the individual does with his own solitariness” (RM 16). Yet it is still Whitehead the algebraist who is constructing this definition. Solitariness is understood as a multi-layered relational modality of the individual in and toward the world. In addition, this relational mode cannot be understood in separation from its history. On this point, Whitehead compares religion with arithmetic. Thus, an understanding of the latter makes no essential reference to its history, whereas for religion such a reference is vital. Moreover, as Whitehead states, “You use arithmetic, but you are religious” (RM 15).

Whitehead also argues that, “The purpose of God is the attainment of value in the temporal world,” and “Value is inherent in actuality itself” (RM 100). Whitehead’s use of the word “God” in the foregoing invites a wide range of habitual assumptions about his meaning, most, if not all, of which will probably be mistaken. The key element for Whitehead is value. God, like arithmetic, is discussed in terms of something which has a purpose. On the other hand, value is like being religious in that it is inherent. It is something that is rather than something that is used.

Shortly after this work, there appeared another book whose brevity betrays its importance, Symbolism its Meaning and Effect (“S,” 1927). Whitehead’s explicit interest in symbols was present in his earliest publication. But in conjunction with his theory of prehension, the theory of symbols came to take on an even greater importance for him. Our “uncognitive” sense-perceptions are directly caught up in our symbolic awareness as is shown by the immediacy with which we move beyond what is directly given to our senses. Whitehead uses the example of a puppy dog that sees a chair as a chair rather than as a patch of color, even though the latter is all that impinges on the dog’s retina. (Whitehead may not have known that dogs are color blind, but this does not significantly affect his example.) Thus, this work further develops Whitehead’s theories of perception and awareness, and does so in a manner that is relatively non-technical. Because of the centrality of the theory of symbols and perception to Whitehead’s later philosophy, this clarity of exposition makes this book a vital stepping stone to what followed.

What followed was Process and Reality (“PR,” 1929). This book is easily one of the most dense and difficult works in the entire Western canon. The book is rife with technical terms of Whitehead’s own invention, necessitated by his struggle to push beyond the inherited limits of the available concepts toward a comprehensive vision of the logical structures of becoming. It is here that we see the problem of space receive its ultimate payoff in Whitehead’s thought. But this payoff comes in the form of a fully relational metaphysical scheme that draws upon his theory of symbols and perception in the most essential manner possible. At the same time, PR plants the seeds for the further engagement of the problem of the accretion of value that is to come in his later work. Because each process of becoming must be considered holistically as an essentially organic unity, Whitehead often refers to his theory as the “philosophy of organism.”

PR invites controversy while defying brief exposition. Many of the relational ideas Whitehead develops are holistic in character, and thus do not lend themselves to the linear presentation of language. Moreover, the language Whitehead needs to build his holistic image of the world is often biological or mentalistic in character, which can be jarring when the topic being discussed is something like an electron. Moreover, Whitehead the algebraist was an intrinsically relational thinker, and explicitly characterized the subject / predicate mode of language as a “high abstraction.” Nevertheless, there are some basic ideas which can be quickly set out.

The first of these is that PR is not about time per se. This has been a subject of much confusion. But Whitehead himself points out that physical time as such only comes about with “reflection” of the “divisibility” of his two major relational types into one another (PR 288 – 9). Moreover, throughout PR, Whitehead continues to endorse the theory of nature found in his earlier triad of books on the subject. So the first step in gaining a handle on PR is to recognize that it is better thought of as addressing the logic of becoming, whereas his books from 1919 – 1922 address the “nature” of time.

The basic units of becoming for Whitehead are “actual occasions.” Actual occasions are “drops of experience,” and relate to the world into which they are emerging by “feeling” that relatedness and translating it into the occasion’s concrete reality. When first encountered, this mode of expression is likely to seem peculiar if not downright outrageous. One thing to note here is that Whitehead is not talking about any sort of high-level cognition. When he speaks of “feeling” he means an immediacy of concrete relatedness that is vastly different from any sort of “knowing,” yet which exists on a relational spectrum where cognitive modes can emerge from sufficiently complex collections of occasions that interrelate within a systematic whole. Also, feeling is a far more basic form of relatedness than can be represented by formal algebraic or geometrical schemata. These latter are intrinsically abstract, and to take them as basic would be to commit the fallacy of misplaced concreteness. But feeling is not abstract. Rather, it is the first and most concrete manifestation of an occasion’s relational engagement with reality.

This focus on concrete modes of relatedness is essential because an actual occasion is itself a coming into being of the concrete. The nature of this “concrescence,” using Whitehead’s term, is a matter of the occasion’s creatively internalizing its relatedness to the rest of the world by feeling that world, and in turn uniquely expressing its concreteness through its extensive connectedness with that world. Thus an electron in a field of forces “feels” the electrical charges acting upon it, and translates this “experience” into its own electronic modes of concreteness. Only later do we schematize these relations with the abstract algebraic and geometrical forms of physical science. For the electron, the interaction is irreducibly concrete.

Actual occasions are fundamentally atomic in character, which leads to the next interpretive difficulty. In his previous works, events were essentially extended and continuous. And when Whitehead speaks of an “event” in PR without any other qualifying adjectives, he still means the extensive variety found in his earlier works (PR 73). But PR deals with a different set of problems from that previous triad, and it cannot take such continuity for granted. For one thing, Whitehead treats Zeno’s Paradoxes very seriously and argues that one cannot resolve these paradoxes if one starts from the assumption of continuity, because it is then impossible to make sense of anything coming immediately before or immediately after anything else. Between any two points of a continuum such as the real number line there are an infinite number of other points, thus rendering the concept of the “next” point meaningless. But it is precisely this concept of the “next occasion” that Whitehead requires to render intelligible the relational structures of his metaphysics. If there are infinitely many occasions between any two occasions, even ones that are nominally “close” together, then it becomes impossible to say how it is that later occasions feel their predecessors – there is an unbounded infinity of other occasions intervening in such influences, and changing it in what are now undeterminable ways. Therefore, Whitehead argued, continuity is not something which is “given;” rather it is something which is achieved. Each occasion makes itself continuous with its past in the manner in which it feels that past and creatively incorporates the past into its own concrescence, its coming into being.

Thus, Whitehead argues against the “continuity of becoming” and in favor of the “becoming of continuity” (PR 68 – 9). Occasions become atomically, but once they have become they incorporate themselves into the continuity of the universe by feeling the concreteness of what has come before and making that concreteness a part of the occasion’s own internal makeup. The continuity of space and durations in Whitehead’s earlier triad does not conflict with his metaphysical atomism, because those earlier works were dealing with physical nature in which continuity has already come into being, while PR is dealing with relational structures that are logically and metaphysically prior to nature.

Most authors believe that the sense of “atomic” being used here is similar to, if not synonymous with, “microscopic.” However, there are reasons why one might want to resist such an interpretation. To begin with, it teeters on the edge of the fallacy of simple location to assume that by “atomic” Whitehead means “very small.” An electron, which Whitehead often refers to as an “electronic occasion,” may have a tiny region of most highly focused effects. But the electromagnetic field that spreads out from that electron reaches far beyond that narrow focus. The electron “feels” and is “felt” throughout this field of influence which is not spatially limited. Moreover, Whitehead clearly states that space and time are derivative notions from extension whereas, “To be an actual occasion in the physical world means that the entity in question is a relatum in this scheme of extensive connection” (PR 288 – 9). The quality of being microscopic is something that only emerges after one has a fully developed notion of space, while actual occasions are logically prior to space and a part of the extensive relations from which space itself is derived. Thus it is at least arguably the case that the sense of “atomic” that Whitehead is employing hearkens back more to the original Greek meaning of “irreducible” than to the microscopic sense that pervades physical science. In other words, the “atomic” nature of what is actual is directly connected to its relational holism.

The structure of PR is also worth attention, for each of the five major parts offers a significant perspective on the whole. Part I gives Whitehead’s defense of speculative philosophy and sets out the “categoreal scheme” underlying PR. The second part applies these categories to a variety of historical and thematic topics. Part three gives the theory of prehensions as these manifest themselves with and through the categories, and is often called the “genetic account.” The theory of extension, or the “coordinate account,” constitutes part four and represents the ultimate development of Whitehead’s rigorous thought on the nature of space. The last and final part presents both a theory of the dialectic of opposites, and the minimalist role of God in Whitehead’s system as the foundation of coherence in the world’s processes of becoming.

Two of the features of part I that stand out are Whitehead’s defense of speculative philosophy, and his proposed resolution of the traditional problem of the One and the Many. “Speculative philosophy” for Whitehead is a phrase he uses interchangeably with “metaphysics.” However, what Whitehead means is a speculative program in the most scientifically honorific sense of the term. Rejecting any form of dogmatism, Whitehead states that his purpose is to, “frame a coherent, logical, necessary system of general ideas in terms of which every element of our experience can be interpreted” (PR 3). The second feature, the solution to the problem of the “one and the many,” is often summarized as, “The many become one, and increase by one.” This means that the many occasions of the universe that have already become contribute their atomic reality to the becoming of a new occasion (“the many become one”). However, this occasion, upon fully realizing in its own atomic character, now contributes that reality to the previously achieved realities of the other occasions (“and increase by one”).

The atomic becoming of an actual occasion is achieved by that occasion’s “prehensive” relations and its “extensive” relations. An actual occasion’s holistically felt and non-sequentially internalized concrete evaluations of its relationships to the rest of the world is the subject matter of the theory of “prehension,” part III of PR. This is easily one of the most difficult and complex portions of that work. The development that Whitehead is describing is so holistic and anti-sequential that it might appropriately be compared to James Joyce’s Finnegan’s Wake. An actual occasion “prehends” its world (relationally takes that world in) by feeling the “objective data” of past occasions which the new occasion utilizes in its own concrescence. This data is prehended in an atemporal and nonlinear manner, and is creatively combined into the occasion’s own manifest self-realization. This is to say that the becoming of the occasion is also informed by a densely teleological sense of the occasion’s own ultimate actuality, its “subjective aim” or what Whitehead calls the occasion’s “superject.” Once it has become fully actualized, the occasion as superject becomes an objective datum for those occasions which follow it, and the process begins again.

This same process of concrescence is described in its extensive characters in part IV, where the mereological (formal relations of part and whole) as well as topological (non-metrical relations of neighborhood and connection) characteristics of extension are developed. Unlike the subtle discussion of prehensions, Whitehead’s theory of extension reads very much like a text book on the logic of spatial relations. Indeed, a great deal of contemporary work in artificial intelligence and spatial reasoning identifies this section of PR as foundational to this field of research, which often goes by the intimidating title of “mereotopology.”

The holistic character of prehension and the analytical nature of extension invite the reader to interpret the former as a theory of “internal relations” and the latter as a theory of “external relations.” Put simply, external relations treat the self-identity of a thing as the first, analytically given fact, while internal relations treat it as the final, synthetically developed result. But Whitehead explicitly associates internal relations with extension, and externality with that of prehension. This seeming paradox can be resolved by noting that, even though prehension is the process of the actual occasion’s “internalizing” the rest of reality as it composes its own self-identity, the achieved result (the superject) is the atomic realization of that occasion in its ultimate externality to the rest of the world. On the other hand, the mereological relations of part and whole from which extension is built, are themselves so intrinsically correlative to one another that each only meaningfully expresses its own relational structures to the extent that it completely internalizes the other.

Whitehead was never one to revisit a problem once he felt he had addressed it adequately. With the publication of PR and the final version of his theory of extension, Whitehead never returned to the ‘problem of space’ except on those limited occasions when his later work required that he mention those earlier developments. Those later works were effectively focused upon the ‘problem of history’ to the exclusion of all else. The primary book on this topic is Adventures of Ideas (“AI,” 1933).

AI is a pithy and engaging book whose opening pages entice the reader with clear and evidently non-technical language. But it is a book that needs to be approached with care. Whitehead assumes, without explanation, knowledge on the part of his readers of the metaphysical scheme of PR, and resorts to the terminology of that book whenever the argument requires it. Indeed, AI is the application of Whitehead’s process metaphysics to the “problem of history.” Whitehead surveys numerous cultural forms from a thoroughly relational perspective, analyzing the ways in which these connections contribute both to the rigidities of culture and the possibilities for novelty in various “adventures” in the accumulation of meanings and values. Many of the forces in this adventure of meaning are blind and senseless, thus presenting the challenge of becoming more deliberate in our processes of building and changing them.

In line with this, two other works bear mentioning: The Function of Reason (“FR,” 1929) and Modes of Thought (“MT,” 1938). FR presents an updated version of Aristotle’s three classes of soul (the vegetative, the animate, and the rational); only in Whitehead’s case, the classifications are, as the title states, functional rather than facultative. Thus, for Whitehead, the function of reason is “promote the art of life,” which is a three-fold function of “(i) to live, (ii) to live well, (iii) to live better” (FR 4, 8). Thus, reason for Whitehead is intrinsically organic in both origin and purpose. But the achievement of a truly reasonable life is a matter that involves more than just the logical organization of propositional knowledge. It is a matter of full and sensitive engagement with the entire lived world. This is the topic of MT, Whitehead’s final major publication. In arguing for a multiplicity of modes of thought, Whitehead offered his final great rebellion against the excessive focus on language that dominated the philosophical thought of his day. In this work, Whitehead also offered his final insight as to the purpose and function of philosophy itself. “The use of philosophy,” Whitehead concluded, “is to maintain an active novelty of fundamental ideas illuminating the social system. It reverses the slow descent of accepted thought towards the inactive commonplace.” In this respect, “philosophy is akin to poetry” (MT 174).

3. Influence and Legacy

Evaluating Whitehead’s influence is a difficult matter. While Whitehead’s influence has never been great, in the opening years of the 21st century it appears to be growing in a broad range of otherwise divergent disciplines. Fulfilling his own vision of the use of philosophy, Whitehead’s ideas are a rich trove of alternative approaches to traditional problems. His thoroughgoing relational and process orientation offers numerous opportunities to reimagine the ways in which the world is connected and how those connections manifest themselves.

The most prominent area of ongoing Whiteheadian influence is within process theology. While Whitehead’s explicit philosophical treatments of God seldom went beyond that of an ideal principle of maximal coherence, many others have developed these ideas further. Writers such as Charles Hartshorne and John Cobb have speculated on, and argued for, a much more robust, ontological conception of God. Nothing in Whitehead’s own writings require such developments, but neither are they in any way precluded. The God of process theology tends to be far more personal and much more of a co-participant in the creative process of the universe than that which one often finds in orthodox religions.

Within philosophy itself, Whitehead’s influence has been smaller and much more diffuse. Yet those influences are likely to crop up in what seem, on the surface at least, to be improbable places. The literature here is too vast to enumerate, but it includes researches from all of the major philosophical schools including pragmatism, analytical, and continental thought. The topics engaged include ontology, phenomenology, personalism, philosophical anthropology, ethics, political theory, economics, etc.

There are also a variety of ways in which Whitehead’s work continues to influence scientific research. This influence is, again, typically found only in the work of widely scattered individuals. However, one area where this is not the case is Whitehead’s theory of extension. Whitehead’s work on the logical basis of geometry is widely cited as foundational in the study of mereotopology, which in turn is of fundamental importance in the study of spatial reasoning, especially in the context of artificial intelligence.

There is also a growing interest in Whitehead’s work within physics, where it is proving to be a valuable source of ideas to help re-conceive the nature of physical relations. This is particularly true of such bizarre phenomena as quantum entanglement, which seems to violate orthodox notions of mechanistic interaction. There is a renewed interest in Whitehead’s arguments regarding relativity, particularly because of their potential tie-in with other bimetric theories of space and gravity. Other areas of interest include biology, where Whitehead’s holistic relationalism again offers alternative models of explanation.

4. References and Further Reading

Those of Whitehead’s primary texts which have been mentioned in the article are listed below in chronological order. More technical works have been “starred” with an asterisk. Original publication dates are given, as well as more recent printings. Of these more recent printings, those done by Dover Publications have been favored because they retain the pagination of the original imprints. On the other hand, the volume of the secondary literature on Whitehead is truly astounding, and a comprehensive list would go far beyond the limits of this article. So while the secondary works listed below can hardly be viewed as definitive, they do offer a useful starting place. The secondary sources are divided into two groups, those that are relatively more accessible and those that are relatively more technical.

a. Primary Sources

  • *A Treatise on Universal Algebra (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1898.)
  • *The Axioms of Projective Geometry (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1906.)
  • *The Axioms of Descriptive Geometry, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1907. Mineaola: Dover Phoenix Editions, 2005.)
    • The two Axioms books are models of expository clarity, yet they are still books on formal mathematics. Hence, they have been reluctantly “starred.”
  • *Principia Mathematica, volumes I – III, with Bertrand Russell (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1910 – 1913.)
  • An Introduction to Mathematics (London: Home University Library of Modern Knowledge, 1911. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1958.)
  • *An Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1919.)
  • The Concept of Nature (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1920. Mineola: Dover, May 2004.)
  • *The Principle of Relativity with Applications to Physical Science (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1922. Mineola: Dover Phoenix Editions, 2004.)
  • Science and the Modern World (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1925. New York: The Free Press, 1967.)
  • Religion in the Making (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1926. New York: Fordham University Press, 1996.)
    • This later edition is particularly useful because of the detailed glossary of terms at the end of the text.
  • Symbolism, Its Meaning and Effect (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1927. New York: Fordham University Press, 1985.)
  • The Aims of Education (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1929. New York: The Free Press, 1967.)
  • **Process and Reality (New York: The Macmillan Company 1929. New York: The Free Press, 1978.)
    • Easily one of the most difficult books in the entire Western philosophical canon, this volume earns two asterisks.
  • The Function of Reason (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1929. Boston: Beacon Press, 1962.)
  • *Adventures of Ideas (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1933. New York: The Free Press, 1985.)
  • Modes of Thought (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1938. New York: The Free Press, 1968.)
  • Essays in Science and Philosophy (New York: Philosophical Library Inc., 1948.)

b. Secondary Sources

(Relatively more accessible secondary texts:)

  • Eastman, Timothy E. and Keeton, Hank (editors): Physics and Whitehead: Quantum, Process, and Experience (Albany: State University of New York Press, January 2004.)
    • This is an important recent survey of some of the ways in which Whitehead’s thought is being employed in contemporary physics.
  • Kraus, Elizabeth M.: The Metaphysics of Experience (New York: Fordham University Press, April 1979.)
    • This book is a particularly useful companion to PR because of the care with which Kraus has flow-charted the relational structures of Whitehead’s argument.
  • Lowe, Victor: Alfred North Whitehead: The Man and his Work, volumes I and II (Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins Press, 1985 & 1990.)
    • These volumes are the definitive biography of Whitehead.
  • Mesle, C. Robert & Cobb, John B.: Process Theology: A Basic Introduction (Atlanta: Chalice Press, September 1994.)
    • This is a solid and very readable survey of contemporary process theology.
  • Schilpp, Paul Arthur, editor: The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead, “The Library of Living Philosophers,” (LaSalle: Open Court Publishing Company, 1951.)
    • This book is a collection of essays on Whitehead’s work by his contemporaries.

(Relatively more technical secondary texts:)

  • Casati, Roberto and Varzi, Achille C.: Parts and Places: The Structures of Spatial Representation (Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press, 1999.)
    • This text is a college level introduction to mereotopology, and includes an extensive bibliography on the subject and its history.
  • Ford, Lewis: Emergence of Whitehead’s Metaphysics, 1925-1929 (Albany: SUNY Press, 1985.)
    • This book is an examination of the historical development of Whitehead’s metaphysical ideas.
  • Hall, David L.: The Civilization of Experience, A Whiteheadian Theory of Culture (New York: Fordham University Press, New 1973.)
    • Hall’s work attempts, among other things, to derive an ethical theory from Whitehead’s metaphysics.
  • Jones, Judith A. Intensity: An Essay in Whiteheadian Ontology (Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 1998.)
    • This work is widely considered to be one of the most important pieces of secondary literature on Whitehead.
  • Nobo, Jorge Luis.: Whitehead’s Metaphysics of Extension and Solidarity (Albany: SUNY Press, 1986.)
  • Palter, William: Whitehead’s Philosophy of Science (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, June 1960.)
    • This work is widely viewed as the definitive text on Whitehead’s theory of science and nature.

Author Information

Gary L. Herstein
Email: gherstein@netzero.net
Southern Illinois University at Carbondale
U. S. A.

God and Time

Any theistic view of the world includes some notion of how God is related to the structures of the universe, including space and time. The question of God’s relation to time has generated a great amount of theological and philosophical reflection. The traditional view has been that God is timeless in the sense of being outside time altogether; that is, he exists but does not exist at any point in time and he does not experience temporal succession. What may be the dominant view of philosophers today is that he is temporal but everlasting; that is, God never began to exist and he never will go out of existence. He exists at each moment in time.

Deciding how best to think of God’s relation to time will involve bringing to bear one’s views about other aspects of the divine nature. How a philosopher thinks about God’s knowledge and his interaction with his people within the temporal world shapes how that philosopher will think about God’s relation to time and vice versa. In addition, other metaphysical considerations also play important roles in the discussion. For example, the nature of time and the nature of the origin of the universe each have a bearing on whether God is best thought of as timeless or temporal.

This article traces the main contours of the contemporary debate. Several versions of the view that God is timeless are explained and the major arguments for timelessness are developed and criticized. Divine temporality is also explored and arguments in its favor are presented along with criticisms. In addition, some views that attempt to occupy a middle ground will be considered.

Table of Contents

  1. God’s Relation to Time — Preliminaries
    1. What it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass
    2. What it Means to be Timeless: A First Pass
    3. Some In-between Views
  2. Methodology
  3. Divine Timelessness
    1. Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration
    2. Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity
    3. Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration
  4. Arguments for Divine Timelessness
    1. God’s Knowledge of the Future
    2. The Fullness of God’s Being
    3. God and the Creation of the Universe
  5. Divine Temporality
  6. Arguments for Temporality
    1. Divine Action in the World
    2. Divine Knowledge of the Present
  7. Some In-between Views
    1. Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless
    2. Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with Creation
  8. Conclusion
  9. References and Further Reading

1. God’s Relation to Time — Preliminaries

Theism is the view that there exists a person who is, in significant ways, unlike every other person. This person, whom we will call “God,” is the creator of the entire universe. Atheism is the view that such a person does not exist. Any theistic world-view includes some notion of how God is related to this universe. There must be some account of how God relates to events, things, and people within the universe and of how God is related to what we could call the structure of the universe. That is, how God is related to space and to time. If God is the creator of the universe, the question arises as to whether God created space and time as well. The answers to these questions turn on whether space and time are parts or aspects of the universe or whether they are more fundamental. Not many theologians or philosophers think that space is more fundamental than the universe. They think that God brought space into being. This view implies that God is in some sense spaceless or “outside” space. God’s relation to time, however, is a topic about which there continues to be deep disagreement. From Augustine through Aquinas, the major thinkers argued that God was not in time at all. They thought of God as eternal, in the sense that he is timeless or atemporal. Now, the dominant view among philosophers is that God is temporal. His eternal nature is thought of as being everlasting rather than timeless. He never came into existence and he will never go out of existence but he exists within time.

Proponents of each of these positions attribute eternality to God. As a result, the term, “eternal” has come to be either ambiguous or a general term that covers various positions. In this article, the term, “eternal” will be used to refer to God’s relation to time, whatever it is. The term “temporal” will refer to God as within time and “timeless” will designate God as being outside time.

a. What it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass

The majority position today, at least among philosophers, is that God is everlasting but temporal. That is, God never began to exist, and he will never go out of existence. God does, however, experience temporal succession. That is, God experiences some events (for example, the first century) before he experiences other events (for example, the twenty-first century.) If God is temporal, his existence and his thoughts and actions have temporal location. He exists at the present moment (and he has existed at each past moment and he will exist at each future moment.) In August, he was thinking about the heat wave in the mid-west. In the thirteenth century, he listened to and answered Aquinas’ prayers for understanding. His dealings, like those of the rest of us, occur at particular times.

b. What it Means to be Timeless: A First Pass

The claim that God is timeless is a denial of the claim that God is temporal. First, God exists, but does not exist at any temporal location. Rather than holding that God is everlastingly eternal, and, therefore, he exists at each time, this position is that God exists but he does not exist at any time at all. God is beyond time altogether. It could be said that although God does not exist at any time God exists at eternity. That is, eternity can be seen as a non-temporal location as any point within time is a temporal location. Second, it is thought that God does not experience temporal succession. God’s relation to each event in a temporal sequence is the same as his relation to any other event. God does not experience the first century before he experiences the twenty-first. Both of these centuries are experienced by God in one “timeless now.” So, while it is true that in the thirteenth century Aquinas prayed for understanding and received it, God’s response to his prayers is not something that also occurred in that century. God, in his timeless state of being, heard Aquinas’ prayers and answered them. He did not first hear them and then answer them. He heard and answered in one timeless moment — in fact, he did so in the same timeless moment that he hears and answers prayers offered in the twenty-first century.

c. Some In-between Views

Some philosophers think that God’s relation to time cannot be captured by either of the categories of temporality or timelessness. Rather, God is in some third kind of relation to time. One in-between position is that God is not within our time, but he is within his own time. In this view, God’s inner life is sequential and, therefore, temporal, but his relation to our temporal sequence is “all at once.” In a sense, God has his own time line. He is not located at any point in our time line. On this view, God’s time does not map onto our time at all. His time is completely distinct from ours.

Another view is that God is “omnitemporal.” It is true on this view as well that God is not in our time, but he experiences temporal succession in his being. Our time is constituted by physical time. God’s time (metaphysical time) has no intrinsic metric and is constituted purely by the divine life itself (Padgett 1992, 2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004). If God is omnitemporal, his metaphysical time does map in some way onto our physical time. So there is a literal sense in which God knows now that I am typing this sentence now.

Another view (Craig, 2001a, 2001b) is that God became temporal when time was created. God’s existence without creation is a timeless existence but once temporal reality comes into existence, God himself must change. If he changes, then he is, at least in some sense, temporal. Just as it is not quite accurate to talk about what happens before time comes into existence, we should not describe this view as one in which God used to be timeless, but he became temporal. This language would imply that there was a time when God was timeless and then, later, there is another time when he is temporal. On this view, there was not a time when he was timeless. God’s timelessness without creation is precisely due to the fact that time came into existence with creation.

2. Methodology

Many philosophers of religion think that the Scriptures do not teach definitively any one view concerning God and time (Craig 2001a, 2001b; for a differing view, see Padgett, 1992). The Scriptures do provide some parameters for acceptable theories of God’s relation to time, however. For example, they teach that God never began to exist and he will never go out of existence. They also teach that God interacts with the world. He knows what is going on, he reveals himself to people, he acts in such a way that things happen in time. They also teach that God is the Lord of all creation. Everything is subject to him. Philosophers generally take claims such as these as parameters for their thinking because of their concern either to remain within historical, biblical orthodoxy themselves or, at least, to articulate a position about God and time that is consistent with orthodoxy. Any departure from the broad outlines of orthodoxy, at least for many Christian philosophers of religion, is made as a last resort.

These parameters, as has been noted, allow for a plurality of positions about how God is related to time. Determining which position is most adequate involves trying to fit what we think about other aspects of God’s nature together with our thinking about God’s relation to time. What we want to say about God’s power or knowledge or omnipresence will have some bearing on our understanding of how it is that God is eternal. In addition, we will try to fit our theories together with other issues besides what God himself is like. Some of the most obvious issues include the nature of time, the nature of change and the creation of the universe.

3. Divine Timelessness

a. Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration

Much of the contemporary discussion of timelessness begins with the article “Eternity” by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981). Stump and Kretzmann take their cue from Boethius who articulated what became a standard understanding of divine timelessness: “Eternity, then, is the whole, simultaneous and perfect possession of boundless life” (Boethius, 1973). Stump and Kretzmann identify four ingredients that they claim are essential to an eternal (timeless) being. (Although they cast their discussion in terms of an “eternal being,” this article will continue to use the term “timeless”.) First, any being that is timeless has life. Second, the life of a timeless thing is not able to be limited. Third, this life involves a special sort of duration. Anything that has life must have duration but the duration of a timeless being is not a temporal duration. Last, a timeless being possesses its entire life all at once. It is this last element that implies that the timeless being is outside time because a temporal living thing only possesses one moment of its life at a time.

The two aspects of divine timelessness that Stump and Kretzmann emphasize are that a timeless being has life and that this life has a duration, though not a temporal duration. The duration of the life of a timeless being puts the nature of such a being in stark contrast with the nature of abstract objects such as numbers or properties. The picture of God that this view leaves us with is of a being whose life is too full to exist only at one moment at a time.

The challenge for a defender of a timeless conception of God is to explain how such a God is related to temporal events. For example, God is directly conscious of each moment of time. The relation of his timeless cognition and the temporal objects of his cognition cannot be captured by using strictly temporal relations such as simultaneity because temporal simultaneity is a transitive relation. God is timelessly aware of the fall of Rome and, in the same timeless now, he is aware of my spilling my coffee. The fall of Rome is not, however, occurring at the same time that my coffee spills. What is needed is some non-transitive notion of God’s relation to the temporal world. To this end, Stump and Kretzmann introduce the notion of “ET (eternal-temporal)-simultaneity:”

(ET) for every x and every y, x and y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:

  1. either x is eternal and y is temporal, or vice versa; and
  2. for some observer, A, in the unique eternal reference frame, x and y are both present — that is, either x is eternally present and y is observed as temporally present, or vice versa; and
  3. for some observer, B, in one of the infinitely many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present — that is, either x is observed as eternally present and y is temporally present, or vice versa. (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981: pp 230-231.)

If x and y are ET-simultaneous, one is timeless and the other temporal. This fact preserves the non-symmetrical and non-transitive nature of the relation. If ET-simultaneity captures the truth about God’s relation to a temporal world, then we do not have to worry about the fall of Rome occurring at the same time that I spill my coffee.

Unfortunately, there are numerous difficulties with ET-simultaneity. Philosophers have complained about obscurity of the use of “reference frame” terminology (for example, Padgett 1992). There is clearly an analogy with relativity theory at work here. To put an analogy at the core of a technical definition is pedagogically suspect, at the least. It may be that it masks a deeper philosophical problem. Furthermore, Delmas Lewis (1984) has argued that a temporal being can observe something only if that thing is itself temporal and a timeless being can observe only what is timeless. Observation cannot cross the temporal/timeless divide. Therefore, the observation talk, as well as the reference frame talk, must be only analogous or metaphorical.

It has also been argued that the notion of atemporal duration, that Stump and Kretzmann hold to be required by the timeless view, is at bottom incoherent. Paul Fitzgerald (1985) has argued that for there to be duration in the life of God, it must be the case that two or more of God’s thoughts, for example, will have either the same or different amounts of duration. Different thoughts in God’s mind can be individuated by their respective lengths of duration or at least by their locations within the duration. Fitzgerald argues that if a timeless duration does not have these analogues with temporal or spatial duration, it is hard to think of it as a case of bona fide duration. On the other hand, if the duration in God’s life has this sort of duration, it is difficult to see that it is not simply one more case of temporal duration.

Stump and Kretzmann attempt to respond to such objections and have revised their analysis of ET-simultaneity accordingly. In their first response to Fitzgerald (Stump and Kretzmann, 1987), they make much of his analyzing timeless duration in a way that makes it incompatible with the traditional doctrine of divine simplicity. They will not accept any notion of God’s life that requires them to give up on the simplicity of the divine nature. For example, there cannot be any sort of sequence among distinct events or “moments” within the duration of God’s life. There are no distinct events or moments at all within the life of a God who is metaphysically simple. Although the two positions are linked throughout medieval thought, there is a cost to holding that a timeless God must be metaphysically simple as well. Any independent argument against divine simplicity (such as in Wolterstorff, 1991) will count against such a view of timelessness.

In a later response, Stump and Kretzmann put forward a new version of ET-simultaneity (called ET’):

(ET’): For every x and every y, x and y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:

  1. either x is eternal and y is temporal or vice versa (assume x is eternal and y temporal);
  2. with respect to some A in the unique eternal reference frame, x and y are both present — that is: (a) x is in the eternal present with respect to A, (b) y is in the temporal present, and (c) both x and y are situated with respect to A in such a way that A can enter into direct and immediate causal relations with each of them and (if capable of awareness) can be directly aware of each of them; and
  3. with respect to some B in one of the infinitely many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present — that is: (a) x is in the eternal present, (b) y is at the same time as B, and (c) both x and y are situated with respect to B in such a way that B can enter into direct and immediate causal relations with each of them and (if capable of awareness) can be directly aware of each of them. (Stump and Kretzmann, 1992)

This version of the principle eliminates the observation difficulties but continues to use the notion of reference frames to describe the timeless and the temporal states. Alan Padgett (1992) has argued that Stump and Kretzmann cannot be defending anything more than a loose analogy with relativity theory here. He points out that they admit that the use of relativity theory is a heuristic device and nothing more. Yet their analysis of the relation between a timeless being and events in time requires more than a loose analogy. As far as the Special Theory of Relativity is concerned, there is an absolute temporal simultaneity or an absolute temporal ordering between any two events within each other’s light cones. The problems with holding that simultaneity is absolute only arise when two events each of which is outside the other’s light cone are considered. If two events are outside each other’s light cones in this way, they cannot causally interact. This feature of Special Relativity makes the analogy of the relations between a timeless being and a temporal event on the one hand and the relations between events in different reference frames quite weak.

b. Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity

Brian Leftow has defended timeless duration in the life of God in another way. He holds that there are distinct moments within God’s life. These moments stand in the successive relations of earlier and later to one another, although they are not temporally earlier or later than one another. Leftow calls this view Quasi-Temporal Eternality (QTE) (Leftow 1991). A QTE being is timeless in that it lives all of its life at once. No moment of its life passes away and there is no moment at which some other moment has not yet been lived. Because the life of a QTE being has sequential moments, its duration is significantly like the duration or extension of the life of a temporal being. Because it experiences all of these moments “at once,” or in the same timeless now, it is a timeless being.

One advantage Leftow thinks his view affords is that it can meet Fitzgerald’s challenges while holding to the doctrine of divine simplicity. There can be the sort of duration that allows discrete moments to be individuated by location in the life of a metaphysically simple, timeless God. Leftow argues that there is a significant difference between a being that has spatial or material parts and a being that has a duration consisting of different moments or positions or points. If the duration of God’s life was made up of discrete parts, God could not be a metaphysically simple being. Points are not parts, however. A finite line segment is not made up of some finite number of points such that the addition or subtraction of a (finite) number of points will change its length. If the points or moments or positions in the duration of the life of God are not to count as parts of that life, they must be of zero finite length.

Fitzgerald had criticized Stump and Kretzmann’s notion of timeless duration by insisting that any duration must be made up of distinct positions. This charge will not affect Leftow’s position. Leftow allows that in the life of a timeless God (and a metaphysically simple God) there are distinct points. He insists that these points are not parts in the life of God. Therefore God is not a being whose life contains distinct parts. He is metaphysically simple. His life does contain points that are ordered sequentially, however. So the QTE God with its sequential points allows God to have the sort of duration that Fitzgerald wanted, yet be timeless. In this way, the QTE concept of timeless duration is more satisfactory than the one put forward by Stump and Kretzmann.

Timeless duration, in Leftow’s understanding, shares features with temporal duration. In a recent essay, he defends the idea that such features can be shared without rendering God temporal (Leftow 2002). He distinguishes between those properties that make something temporal and those that are typically temporal. A typically temporal property (TTP) is a property that is typical of temporal events and which helps make them temporal. Having some TTP is not sufficient to make an event a temporal event, however. What will make an event temporal is having the right TTPs. Leftow notes that nearly everyone who argues that God is timeless also holds that God’s life has at least some TTPs. Similarly, no one who holds that God is temporal thinks that God has every TTP. For example, being wholly future relative to some temporal event is a TTP; but God, even if he is temporal, does not have that property. God has no beginning. As a result his life is not wholly future to any temporal event.

God’s life, like any life, is an event, but it is one in which time does not pass and in which no change takes place. This description captures what is meant by a timeless duration. While having a duration and being an event are each cases of TTPs, Leftow has well-argued that they are not the sort of TTP that only temporal beings can have. God’s life, then, can be a timeless duration.

Which other TTPs does God have if he is timeless? God’s life also has a present, Leftow argues. Having a present is a TTP, but God’s present is a non-temporal present. God’s “now” is not a temporal now. “Now” is the answer to the question asked of some event, “When does it occur?” The term, “now,” according to Leftow, picks out when the speaker tokens it. Not all whens are times, however. Eternity, in the sense of being a timeless location, can also be a when (see also Leftow 1991). “At eternity” can be the answer to the question, “When does God act?”

Leftow’s analysis of these typically temporal properties shows that some of the objections to timeless duration and a timeless God’s relation to a temporal world are not decisive. A timeless God can be present, though not temporally present, to the world. He can have a life which is an event having duration, though not temporal duration. So the critics of Stump and Kretzmann are correct in so far as they argue that these properties are the sort of things that make their bearers temporal. It may be that though things that have these properties are typically temporal, they are not necessarily so.

c. Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration

Katherin Rogers (1994, 2000) has argued that both Leftow and Stump and Kretzmann have not succeeded in articulating a compelling, or even coherent, notion of divine timeless duration. She challenges their claims that the views of timelessness found in Boethius and other medieval thinkers include duration. These texts, she argues, are at best ambiguous. Given their background in Plotinus and Augustine, Rogers argues that it is better not to read these philosophers as attributing duration to the life of God. Augustine and Anselm especially express the notion of timelessness by the use of the notion of the present.

Even if the medieval thinkers did think of timelessness as involving duration, the more difficult question is whether we ought to think about it in this way. Rogers points out that both Stump and Kretzmann and Leftow, in defending the notion of divine timelessness against common objections do not make use of their distinctive notions of timeless duration at all. Furthermore, the explanations given of the coherence of timeless duration are not compelling.

Stump and Kretzmann use the analogy of two parallel lines (Stump and Kretzmann 1987: 219). The higher one is completely illuminated (all at once) while the lower has illuminated a point at a time moving with uniform speed. The light on each line represents the indivisible present. The entirety of the timeless line is one indivisible present while each point on the temporal line is a present (one at a time). In this way the life of God is stretched out, so to speak, alongside temporal reality.

This analogy breaks down at crucial points. Rogers argues that the line representing timelessness (call this line, “E”) either is made of distinct points or it is not. It if is not, then timelessness has no duration. If it is, then these points must correspond in some way to the points on the temporal line (called “T”). The geometric aspect of the analogy is strained considerably when it is seen that some point on T (call it T1) is going to be much closer to a point on E (E1) then the point T235 will be. Yet all of God’s life must stand in the same relation to each point in time, if God is to be truly timeless. Rogers points out that such an analogy is never found in the medieval writers. Their favorite geometric analogy is the circle and the point at the center. The circle represents all of time and the dot, timelessness. Timelessness stands in the same relation to each point along the temporal array. The point itself has no extension or parts.

If God is a QTE being, then his timeless life does have earlier and later points. These are not experienced by God sequentially, however. They are experienced all at once in the one timeless now. Rogers argues that Leftow has two options. Either he must argue for a principled distinction between there being moments in God’s life and his experiencing these moments (such that the moments can exist sequentially but be experienced all at once) or he must grant that earlier and later moments of God’s life can also be simultaneous. Neither alternative increases the plausibility or the clarity of the claim that God’s life has timeless duration.

Rogers offers a non-geometric analogy, found in Augustine (1993), that captures the relation between a timeless God and temporal reality. God’s relation to the world is similar to human memory of the past. Just as in one present mental exercise, a human being can call to mind a whole series of events that are themselves sequential, God in his timeless state can know the whole sequence of temporal events non-sequentially.

Rogers’s position, then, is that God’s timeless life does not involve duration. She does not think that denying duration to God’s life reduces it to some kind of frozen or static existence. These terms are temporal in nature. They each imply a motionless state through a period of time. She writes, “With the exception of lacking extension, God is nothing like a geometric point” (Rogers, 1994, p 14). His life does, however, lack extension.

4. Arguments for Divine Timelessness

Although there are many arguments for the claim that God is timeless, this essay will look at three of the most important. These are arguments concerning God’s knowledge of future free actions, the fullness of God’s life, and God’s creation of the universe. In addition, we will look at some responses to these arguments.

a. God’s Knowledge of the Future

The most prominent argument for divine timelessness is that this position offers a solution to the problem of God’s foreknowledge of free actions. The challenge of reconciling human freedom and divine omniscience is best seen if we presume that God is temporal. If God is omniscient and infallible, he knows every truth, and he is never mistaken. If human beings are free in a libertarian sense, then some actions a person performs are up to her in the sense that she can initiate or refrain from initiating the action. The problem arises if it is supposed that someone will (in the future) choose freely some particular action. Suppose Jeanie will decide tomorrow to make a cup of tea at 4:00 pm. If this is a free act on her part, it must be within her power to make the cup of tea or to refrain from making it. If God is in time and knows everything, then hundreds of years ago, he already knew that Jeanie would make the cup of tea. When tomorrow comes, can Jeanie refrain from making the cup of tea? As Nelson Pike has argued, (Pike 1965) she can do so only if it is within her power to change what it was that God believed from the beginning of time. So, although God has always believed that she would make the tea, she must have the power to change what it was that God believed. She has to be able to make it the case that God always believed that she would not make the cup of tea. Many philosophers have argued that no one has this kind of power over the past, so human freedom is not compatible with divine foreknowledge.

If God is timeless, however, it seems that this problem does not arise. God does not believe things at points in time and Jeanie does not, therefore, have to have power over God’s past beliefs. She does need power over his timeless beliefs. This power is not seen to be problematic because God’s timeless knowledge of an event is thought to be strongly analogous to our present knowledge of an event. It is the occurring of the event that determines the content of our knowledge of the event. So too, it is the occurring of the event that determines the content of God’s knowledge. If Jeanie makes a cup of tea, God knows it timelessly. If she refrains, he knows that she refrains. God’s knowledge is not past but it is timeless.

One might argue that even if God is temporal, the content of his foreknowledge is determined by the occurring of the event in the same way. This claim, of course, is true. There are two items which allow for difficulty here. First, it is only in the case of a temporal God foreknowing Jeanie’s making tea that she needs to have counterfactual power over the past, Second, if God knew a hundred years ago that she was going to make tea, there is a sense in which she can “get in between” God’s knowledge and the event. In other words, the fact that God knows what he knows is fixed before she initiated the event. If it is a free choice on her part, she can still refrain from making the tea. Her decision to make tea or not stands temporally between the content of God’s beliefs and the occurring of the event.

The position that God is timeless is often cited as the best solution to the problem of reconciling God’s knowledge of the future and human freedom. If God is timeless, after all, he does not foreknow anything. Boethius, Anselm, Aquinas and many others have appealed to God’s atemporality to solve this problem.

While the proposal that God is timeless seems to offer a good strategy, at least one significant problem remains. This problem is that of prophecy. Suppose God tells Moses, among other things, that Jeanie will make a cup of tea tomorrow. Now we have a different situation entirely. While God’s knowledge that Jeanie will make a cup of tea is not temporally located, Moses’ knowledge that Jeanie will make tea is temporally located. Furthermore, since the information came from God, Moses cannot be mistaken about the future event (Widerker 1991, Wierenga, 1991).

The prophet problem is a problem, some will argue, only if God actually tells Moses what Jeanie will do. God, it seems, does not tell much to Moses or any other prophet. After all, why should God tell Moses? Moses certainly does not care about Jeanie’s cup of tea. Since prophecy of this sort is pretty rare, we can be confident that God’s knowledge does not rule out our freedom. Some have argued, however, that if it is even possible for God to tell Moses (or anyone else for that matter) what Jeanie will do, then we have a version of the same compatibility problem we would have if we held that God is in time and foreknows her tea making. We could call this version, the “possible prophet” problem. If the possible prophet problem is serious enough to show that God’s timeless knowledge of future acts (future, that is, from our present vantage point) is incompatible with those acts being free, then holding God to be timeless does not solve the problem of foreknowledge.

b. The Fullness of God’s Being

In thinking about God’s nature, we notice that whatever God is, he is to the greatest degree possible. He knows everything that it is possible to know. He can do anything that it is possible to do. He is maximally merciful. This “maximal property idea” can be applied as well to the nature of God’s life. God is a living being. He is not an abstract object like a number. He is not inanimate like a magnetic force. He is alive. If whatever is true of him is true of him to the greatest degree possible, then his life is the fullest life possible. Whatever God’s life is like, he surely has it to the fullest degree.

Some philosophers have argued that this fact about God’s life requires that he be timeless. No being that experiences its life sequentially can have the fullest life possible. Temporal beings experience their lives one moment at a time. The past is gone and the future is not yet. The past part of a person’s life is gone forever. He can remember it, but he cannot experience it directly. The future part of his life is not yet here. He can anticipate it and worry about it, but he cannot yet experience it. He only experiences a brief slice of his life at any one time. The life of a temporal thing, then, is spread out and diffuse.

It is the transient nature of our experience that gives rise to much of the wistfulness and regret we may feel about our lives. This feeling of regret lends credibility to the idea that a sequential life is a life that is less than maximally full. Older people sometimes wish for earlier days, while younger people long to mature. We grieve for the people we love who are now gone. We grieve also for the events and times that no longer persist.

When we think about the life of God, it is strange to think of God longing for the past or for the future. The idea that God might long for some earlier time or regret the passing of some age seems like an attribution of weakness or inadequacy to God. God in his self-sufficiency cannot in any way be inadequate. If it is the experience of the passage of time that grounds these longings, there is good reason not to attribute any experience of time to God. Therefore, it is better to think of God as timeless. He experiences all of his life at once in the timeless present. Nothing of his life is past and nothing of it is future. Boethius’ famous definition of eternity captures this idea: “Eternity, then, is the whole, simultaneous and perfect possession of boundless life” (Boethius, 1973). Boethius contrasts this timeless mode of being with a temporal mode: “Whatever lives in time proceeds in the present and from the past into the future, and there is nothing established in time which can embrace the whole space of its life equally, but tomorrow surely it does not yet grasp, while yesterday it has already lost” (Boethius, 1973).

However, those who think that God is in some way temporal do not want to attribute weakness or inadequacy to God. Nor do they hold that God’s life is less than maximally full. They will deny, rather, that God cannot experience a maximally full life if he is temporal. These philosophers will point out that many of our regrets about the passage of time are closely tied to our finitude. It is our finitude that grounds our own inadequacy, not our temporality. We regret the loss of the past both because our lives are short and because our memories are dim and inaccurate. God’s life, temporal though it may be, is not finite and his memory is perfectly vivid. He does not lose anything with the passage of time. Nor does his life draw closer to its end. If our regrets about the passage of time are more a function of our finitude than of our temporality, much of the force of these considerations is removed.

One important issue that this argument concerning the fullness of God’s life ought to put to rest is the idea that those who hold God to be timeless hold that God is something inert like a number or a property. Whether or not they are correct, the proponent of timelessness holds that it is the fullness of God’s life (rather than its impoverishment) that determines his relation to time.

c. God and the Creation of the Universe

Another argument for God’s timelessness begins with the idea that time itself is contingent. If time is contingent and God is not, then it is at least possible that God exist without time. This conclusion is still far from the claim that God is, in fact, timeless but perhaps we can say more. If time is contingent, then it depends upon God for its existence. Either God brought time into existence or he holds it in existence everlastingly. (The claim that time is contingent, though, is not uncontroversial. Arguments for the necessity of time will be considered below.)

If God created time as part of his creation of the universe, then it is important whether or not the universe had a beginning at all. Although it might seem strange to think that God could create the universe even if the universe had no beginning, it would not be strange to philosophers such as Thomas Aquinas. Working within the Aristotelean framework, he considered an everlasting universe to be a very real possibility. He argued (in his third way) that even a universe with an infinite past would need to depend upon God for its existence. In his view, even if time had no beginning, it was contingent. God sustains the universe, and time itself, in existence at each moment that it exists.

The majority position today is that the universe did have a beginning. What most people mean by this claim is that the physical universe began. It is an open question for many whether time had a beginning or whether the past is infinite. If the past is infinite, then it is metaphysical time and not physical time that is everlasting. Arguments such as the Kalam Cosmological Argument aim to show that it is not possible that the past is infinite (Craig and Smith, 1993; Craig 2001b). Suppose time came into existence with the universe so that the universe has only a finite past. This means that physical time was created by God. It may be the case that metaphysical time is infinite or that God created “pure duration” (metaphysical time) also. In the latter case, God had to be timeless. God created both physical and metaphysical time and God existed entirely without time. God, then, had to be timeless. Unless God became temporal at some point, God remains timeless.

5. Divine Temporality

The position that God is temporal sometimes strikes the general reader as a position that limits the nature of God. Philosophers who defend divine temporality are committed to a similar methodology to that held by those who are defenders of timelessness. They aim to work within the parameters of historical, biblical orthodoxy and to hold to the maximal property idea that whatever God is, he is to the greatest possible degree. Thus, proponents of divine temporality will hold that God is omniscient and omnipotent. God’s temporality is not seen as a limit to his power or his knowledge or his being. Those who hold to a temporal God often work on generating solutions to the challenge of divine foreknowledge and human freedom. They work within the notion that God knows whatever can be known and is thus omniscient. Even those philosophers who argue that God cannot know future free actions defend divine omniscience. They either think that there are no truths about future free actions or that none of those truths can be known, even by God (Hasker, 1989 and Pinnock et al., 1994). God is omniscient because he knows everything that can be known. Divine temporality is not a departure from orthodox concepts of God.

In fact, it is often the commitment to biblical orthodoxy itself that generates the arguments that God is best thought of as temporal. After all, the Pslamist affirms that God is ‘from everlasting to everlasting.’ (Psalm 90:2) It looks like what is affirmed is God’s everlasting temporality. Two of these arguments will be discussed: the argument that divine action in the world requires temporality and the argument that God’s knowledge of tensed facts requires that he be temporal.

6. Arguments for Temporality

a. Divine Action in the World

God acts in the world. He created the universe and he sustains it in existence. God’s sustaining the universe in its existence at each moment is what keeps the universe existing from moment to moment. If, at any instant, it were not sustained, it would cease to exist. If God sustains the universe by performing different actions at different moments of time, then he changes from moment to moment. If God changes, then he is temporal.

God’s interventions in the world are often interactions with human beings. He redeems his people, answers their prayer, and forgives their sin. He also comes to their aid and comforts and strengthens them. Can a proponent of divine timelessness make sense of God interacting in these ways? It all depends, of course, on what the necessary conditions for interaction turn out to be. If it is not possible to answer a request (a prayer) unless the action is performed after the request, then the fact that God answers prayer will guarantee that he is temporal. Some thinkers have thought that an answer can be initiated only after a request. Others have argued that, although answers to requests normally come after the request, it is not necessary that they do so. In order to count as an answer, the action must occur because of the request. Not any because of relation will do, however. An answer is not normally thought of as being caused by the request, yet a cause-effect relation is a kind of because of relation. Answers are contingent whereas effects of causes are in some sense necessary. The because of relation that is relevant to answering a request has to do with intention or purpose.

In some cases, it seems that it is not necessary for the request to come before the answer. If a father knows that his daughter will come home and ask for a peanut butter sandwich, he can make the sandwich ahead of time. There is some sense in which he is responding to her request, even if he has not yet been asked. If the relation between a request and an answer is not necessarily a temporal one, then a timeless God can answer prayer. He hears all our prayers in his one timeless conscious act and in that same conscious act, he wills the answers to our various requests.

Perhaps the effects of God’s actions are located successively in time but his acting is not. In one eternal act he wills the speaking to Moses at one time and the parting of the sea at another. So Moses hears God speaking from the bush at one time and much later Moses sees God part the sea. But in God’s life and consciousness, these actions are not sequential. He wills timelessly both the speaking and the parting. The sequence of the effects of God’s timeless will does not imply that God’s acts themselves are temporal.

b. Divine Knowledge of the Present

Although God’s knowledge of the future is thought by many to be a strong support for divine timelessness, many philosophers think that God’s knowledge of the present strongly supports his temporality. If God knows everything, he must know what day it is today. If God is timeless, so the argument goes, he cannot know what day it is today. Therefore, he must be temporal. (This argument is put forward in various ways by Craig, 2001a, 2001b; DeWeese, 2004; Hasker, 2002; Kretzmann, 1966; Padgett, 1992, 2001 and Wolterstorff, 1975.)

To get at the claim that a timeless God cannot know what day it is, we can start with the facts that a timeless God cannot change and that God knows everything it is possible to know. But if God knows that today is December 13, 2006, tomorrow he will know something else. He will know that yesterday it was December 13, 2006 and that today is December 14, 2006. So God must know different things at different times. If the contents of God’s knowledge changes, he changes. If he changes, he is temporal and not timeless.

The quick answer to this concern is to deny that God knows something different at different times. First, it is obvious that someone who holds that God is timeless does not think that God knows things at times at all. God’s knowings are not temporally located even if what he knows is temporally located. It is not true, it will be insisted, that God knows something today. He knows things about today but he knows these things timelessly.

God knows that today is December 13 in that he knows that the day I refer to when I use the word “today” in writing this introduction is December 13. When we raise the question again tomorrow (“Can a timeless God know what day it is today?”), God knows that this second use of “today” refers to December 14. Temporal indexical terms such as “today,” “tomorrow,” and “now” refer to different temporal locations with different uses. In this way they are similar to terms such as “here,” “you,” and “me.” The point is that the meaning of any sentence involving an indexical term depends upon the context of its use. Since indexical terms may refer to different items with different uses, we can make such sentences more clear by replacing the indexical term with a term whose reference is fixed.

The sentence, “I am now typing this sentence” can be clarified by replacing the indexical terms with other terms that make the indexicals explicit. For example, “I type this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006.” Even better is “Ganssle types this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006.” These sentences, it can be claimed, express the same proposition. In the same way, “I am now writing here” can be clarified as “Ganssle writes on December 13, 2006 at11:58 AM (EST) in Panera Bread in Hamden, CT.” God, of course, knows all of the propositions expressed by these non-indexical sentences. Furthermore, the content of his knowledge does not need to change day to day. The proposition expressed by a non-indexical sentence is true timelessly (or everlastingly) if it is true at all. The proposition expressed by the sentence, “Ganssle types this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006” will be true tomorrow and the next day and so on. God can know these things and be changeless. He can, therefore, be timeless.

There are many philosophers who reject this quick answer on the grounds that God can know all of the non-indexical propositions and still not know what is happening now. This kind of objection raises the second approach to the question of a timeless God’s knowledge of the present. This approach is not through change but through omniscience. I can know that you type a sentence at some date (call the date, t1) without knowing whether or not you are typing the sentence now. I might fail to know that t1 is now. A timeless God can know all propositions expressed by sentences of the form “event e occurs at tn.” Sentences of the form, “event e occurs now,” so the objection goes, express different propositions. In order for God to be omniscient, he must know all propositions. If some sentences are essentially indexical (if they do not express the same propositions as sentences of the form “event e occurs at tn“), he cannot know them. If a timeless God cannot know this kind of proposition, he is not omniscient.

There have been two basic kinds of responses to this line of argument. The first is to deny that there are propositions that are irreducibly indexical in this way. In knowing every proposition of the form “event e occurs at tn,” God knows every proposition about events. This response is, in effect, a defense of the quick answer given above. While this position has its adherents, it involves a commitment to the B-theory of time. The B-theory of time (also known as the tenseless theory or the stasis theory) entails the claim that the most fundamental features of time are the relations of “before,” “after,” and “simultaneous with.” Talk of tenses (past, present and future) can be reduced to talk about these relations. The temporal now is not an objective feature of reality but is a feature of our experience of reality. If the B-theory of time is true, this objection to divine timelessness is undermined.

Those who think that there are propositions about events that cannot be reduced to propositions of the form “event e occurs at tn,” hold the A-theory of time (or tensed or process theory.) The A-theory claims that there is an objective temporal now. This now is not a feature only of our subjective experience of reality but it is a piece of the furniture of the universe. Another way to explain this is that even if there were no temporal minds, the property of occurring now would be exemplified by some events and not others. There would be facts about what is happening now. The fundamental temporal properties are the tensed properties. So events objectively are past, present or future. They are not past, present or future only in virtue of their relation to other events. (The distinction between the A-theory and the B-theory of time was first articulated by J. M. E. McTaggart; see McTaggart, 1993.)

There are different versions of the A-theory and different versions of the B-theory. It is not for this essay to canvass all of these versions or to weigh the evidence for or against any of them. (For more information, see Le Poidevin and MacBeath, 1993; Oaklander and Smith, 1994; and the section “Are there Essentially Tensed Facts?” of the article on Time in this encyclopedia.) Suffice it to say that the A-theory is held more commonly than the B-theory. If the claim that all propositions about events can be reduced to propositions of the form “event e occurs at tn” entails a controversial theory of time, it will not be as successful a defense as many would like. This consideration, to be sure, does not mean that it might not be the correct response, but the burden of defending it is greater accordingly.

Another sort of response to the claim that divine omniscience requires that God is temporal is to embrace the conclusion of the argument and to hold that God is not propositionally omniscient even if he is factually omniscient. In other words, God knows every fact but there are some propositions that can be known only by minds that are located indexically. God is not lacking any fact. His access to each fact, though, is not indexical (Wierenga, 1989, 2002). He knows the same fact I know when I think “I am writing here today.” The proposition through which he knows this fact, however, is different than the proposition through which I know it. God knows the fact through the non-indexical proposition “Ganssle writes in Panera on December 13, 2006.” Embracing this solution is not without its costs. First of all we have to adjust how we describe God’s omniscience. We cannot describe it in terms of God’s knowing every proposition. It is not true, on this view, that God knows every proposition. God knows every fact.

One way to object to this view is to deny that propositions expressed by indexical and non- indexical sentences refer to or assert the same fact. To take this road is to hold that some facts are essentially indexical rather than just that some sentences or propositions are. This objection does not seem too plausible because of stories like the following. Suppose you assert to me (truly) “You are in the kitchen,” and I assert to you (also truly), “I am in the kitchen.” These sentences are not identical and, according to the view we are considering, they express different propositions. What makes both of these assertions true is one and the same fact; the fact consisting in a particular person (Ganssle) being in a particular place (the kitchen). My knowledge of this fact is mediated through a proposition that is expressed by sentences using the indexical “I” and your knowledge is mediated through propositions expressed by sentences using “you.” If there is one fact that makes these different indexical sentences true, it seems that there can be one fact that makes the following two indexical sentences true: “Ganssle is now typing” and “Ganssle types on December 13, 2006.” If these sentences are made true by the same fact, God can know all facts even if he does not know some facts in the same we know them. Our knowledge of facts is conditioned by our indexical location. That is, we know them the way we do in virtue of our personal, spatial and temporal coordinates.

A third response is possible. This response can be combined with the second and that is to deny that God’s knowledge is mediated by propositions at all. William Alston has argued that God knows what he knows without having any beliefs. God’s knowledge is constituted instead by direct awareness of the facts involved. This view entails that God’s omniscience is not to be cashed out in terms of propositions. Furthermore, if God’s knowledge of a fact consists in the presence of that fact to God’s consciousness, it may be that this presence does not affect God intrinsically. If this is the case, God can be aware of different facts in their different temporal locations without himself changing. Whether a strategy such as this one will succeed is an open question (Alston 1989; Ganssle 1993, 1995, 2002c).

Many philosophers who argue for divine temporality structure their arguments as follows: If God is timeless, the B-theory of time must be true. But the B-theory of time is false. Therefore, God is not timeless. Philosophers who defend divine timelessness, then, take one of two tacks. Either they embrace the first premise and hold to the B-theory of time (Helm 1988, 2001; Rogers 2000) or they argue against the second premise. God can be timeless even if the A-theory of time is true. In this case, they try to show that a timeless God can know tensed facts without changing himself. Some advocates of timelessness will try to reconcile their view with the A-theory whether or not it is the theory of time they hold. Since the A-theory is the more widely held, showing God’s timelessness to be compatible with it helps strengthen the overall case for timelessness.

7. Some In-between Views

a. Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless

Alan Padgett and Gary DeWeese (Padgett 1992, 2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004) have each argued that God is not in physical time although he is everlastingly temporal. God’s time is metaphysical time. Padgett and DeWeese, as is to be expected, emphasize different things in the details. For example, Padgett allows for the coherence of a timeless God while DeWeese would endorse the view that any timeless entity is causally inert. No person, then, can be timeless. Only abstract objects such as numbers and properties can exist outside time. Nevertheless, their positions are similar enough to treat them together. The claim that God is “relatively timeless” or “omnitemporal” allows its proponents to endorse some of the criticisms of divine timelessness and, at the same time, affirm some of the arguments for timelessness. Each affirms the argument that God can be timeless only if the B-theory of time is true and that the B-theory is false. They also can hold that God’s life cannot be contained in the measured moments of physical time. They each also affirm that God created time (physical time) as he created the physical universe.

It is with these latter claims that they make the distinction between physical and metaphysical time. Physical time is metric time. In other words, it is time that has an intrinsic metric due to regularities in the physical universe. Events such as the earth revolving around the sun are regular enough to mark off units of time. Metaphysical time involves no metric or measured temporal intervals. God, in himself, is immune from temporal measure. These temporal items depend upon the physical measure of time. This measure is a function of the regular processes that follow physical laws. Since God is not subject to the laws of nature, he is not subject to measured time. He does experience a temporal now, somewhat as we do, but his intrinsic experience is not measured by regular, law-like intervals. He experiences temporal succession, but this succession is that of the progression of his own consciousness and actions rather than that of any external constraints. Now that God has created a universe that unfolds according to regular laws, there is a metric within created time. So while God’s now coincides with the now of physical time, the measured intervals do not belong to his divine life.

These positions combine some of the strengths both of the temporalist with strengths of the timelessness position. The challenge might consist in finding a stable middle ground between timelessness and temporality. When metaphysical time is described as being without metric and without law-like intervals, and perhaps even that God does not change before physical time is created, it becomes more difficult to see the difference between this position and timelessness. The main difference is that on this view, God remains temporal and capable of change even when no change happens in the divine life (for example, before creation). On the other hand, when the co-location of God’s experience of his now and the now of physical time is emphasized, the distinction between the two becomes more difficult to see. William Lane Craig, who holds a similar position, identifies God’s time with the absolute time that was posited by Newton (Craig 2001a, 2001b, 2002). With this notion in place, one can see that physical time is that to which the Special Theory of Relativity applies. Craig and others insist that if relativity theory is interpreted along neo-Lorentzian lines rather than along the lines recommended by Einstein, there is room for a privileged reference frame and, therefore, a cosmic time (Craig 2002). But this cosmic or “absolute” time may still apply only to this universe and not to God.

b. Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with Creation

William Lane Craig’s own position includes another variation. He holds that God is temporal in that he is within metaphysical time. This feature of God’s life is due to the creation of time. Once God created the universe, he became temporal. Prior to creation, God was timeless. Of course, it is not right to say “prior to creation” in any literal sense. The way Craig describes his view is that God without creation is timeless; God with creation is temporal.

If God has shifted his eternal position in this way, then some of the arguments against timelessness or against temporality will have to be rejected. For example, God in his timeless state is omniscient. He is not lacking any knowledge at all. God must know, in his timeless state, that I am typing now. If God (without creation) can know that I am typing now, then it seems that a timeless God with creation can know that I am typing now. Therefore, God’s timelessness is not incompatible with the A-theory of time (Hasker 2003). Craig’s response is that until the universe is created, there is no time and so all tensed propositions are false. What God, in his timeless state without creation knows is the tenseless proposition “Ganssle types on December 14, 2006.” Once the universe is created, time is real and these tenseless sentences do not capture all the facts there are. In order to be omniscient once time exists, God must also know that I type now.

The challenge with this response is that it appears to endorse some of the strategies to make the B-theory work. Remember the A-theory of time is the view that the most fundamental things about time are the locations of past, present and future. The B-theory holds that the most fundamental aspects of time are the relations before, after, and simultaneous with. On Craig’s view, it is hard to argue that the A-locations are more fundamental than the B-relations when there can be facts of the B-sort that have no A-locations. Without creation, it is a fact that I type this sentence on December 14, 2006. Once time is created, there are further facts such as whether I type it now, or have already done so. The fact that I type it on December 14 seems to be more fundamental than the facts that come into existence when time is created.

Craig’s position raises another interesting question. Is it possible for a timeless being to become temporal or for a temporal being to become timeless? The philosophers whose views have been discussed will disagree about the answer to this question. Stump and Kretzmann, for example, would not think such a change possible. Their view of divine timelessness is deeply connected with divine simplicity which, in turn, is seen to be part of God’s essential nature. DeWeese also would not allow for this sort of change since no timeless being can be a person or stand in any causal relations on his view. Craig thinks that it is possible.

8. Conclusion

Questions about God’s relation to time involve many of the most perplexing topics in metaphysics. These include the nature of the fundamental structures of the universe as well as the nature of God’s own life. It is not surprising that the questions are still open even after over two millennia of careful inquiry. While philosophers often come to conclusions that are reasonably settled in their mind, they are wise to hold such conclusions with an open hand.

9. References and Further Reading

  • Alston, William P. (1989). “Does God Have Beliefs?” in Divine Nature and Human Language. Ithaca: Cornell University Press: 178-193.
  • Aquinas. (1945). Introduction to St. Thomas Aquinas. ed., Anton C. Pegis New York: Modern Library.
  • Augustine. (1960). The Confessions of St. Augustine. trans. John K Ryan. New York: Image Books.
  • Augustine. (1993). On Free Choice of the Will. trans. Thomas Williams. Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Boethius. (1973). Tractates; The Consolation of Philosophy. Translated by H. F. Stewart and E. K. Rand, and S. J. Tester. (Loeb Classical Library) Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Castaneda, Hector Neri. (1967) “Omniscience and Indexical Reference,” The Journal of Philosophy 64: 203 210.
  • Craig, William Lane and Quentin Smith. (1993). Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Craig, William Lane. (2001a). Time and Eternity: Exploring God’s Relationship to Time. Wheaton, IL: Crossway Books.
  • Craig, William Lane. (2001b). “Timelessness and Omnitemporality,” in Ganssle (2001a): 129-160.
  • Craig, William Lane. (2002). “The Elimination of Absolute Time by the Special Theory of Relativity,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002): 129-152.
  • DeWeese, Garrett J. (2002) “Atemporal, Sempiternal or Omnitemporal: God’s Temporal Mode of Being,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 49-61.
  • DeWeese, Garrett J. (2004). God and the Nature of Time. Hampshire UK: Ashgate.
  • Fitzgerald, Paul. (1985). “Stump and Kretzmann on Time and Eternity,” The Journal of Philosophy 82: 260 269.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (1993). “Atemporality and the Mode of Divine Knowledge,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion, 34: 171-180.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (1995). “Leftow on Direct Awareness and Atemporality,” Sophia 34: 30-3.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (2001a) ed., God and Time: Four Views. Downers Grove, IL: Inter Varsity Press.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (2001b). “Introduction: Thinking about God and Time,” in Ganssle (2001a): 9-27.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. and David M. Woodruff (2002a) ed., God and Time: Essays on the Divine Nature. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (2002b). “Introduction,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 3-18.
  • Ganssle, Gregory E. (2002c). “Direct Awareness and God’s Experience of a Temporal Now,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 165-181.
  • Hasker, William.(1989). God, Time, and Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Hasker, William. (2002). “The Absence of a Timeless God,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 182-206.
  • Hasker, William. (2003). “Review of God and Time: Four Views ed., Gregory E. Ganssle and God, Time and Eternity by William Lane Craig,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion 54: 111-114.
  • Helm, Paul. (1988). Eternal God: A Study of God without Time. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Helm, Paul. (2001). “Divine Timeless Eternity,” in Ganssle (2001a): 28-60.
  • Kretzmann, Norman. (1966). “Omniscience and Immutability,” The Journal of Philosophy 63: 409 421.
  • Leftow, Brian. (1991). Time and Eternity. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Leftow, Brian. (2002). “The Eternal Present,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 21-48.
  • Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath (1993) ed., Philosophy of Time. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Lewis, Delmas. (1984). “Eternity Again: A Reply to Stump and Kretzmann,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 15: 73-79.
  • McTaggart, J.M.E. (1993). “The Unreality of Time,” in Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath: 23-34.
  • Oaklander, L. Nathan and Quentin Smith (1994) ed., The New Theory of Time. New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Padgett, Alan G. (1992). God, Eternity and the Nature of Time. London: Macmillan. (Reprint, Wipf and Stock, 2000).
  • Padgett, Alan G. (2001). “Eternity as Relative Timelessness,” in Ganssle (2001a): 92-110.
  • Pike, Nelson. (1965). “Divine Omniscience and Voluntary Action,” Philosophical Review 74: 27- 46.
  • Pike, Nelson. (1970). God and Timelessness. New York: Schocken Books.
  • Pinnock, Clark, Richard Rice, John Sanders, William Hasker, David Basinger. (1994). The Openness of God: A Biblical Challenge to the Traditional Understanding of God. Downers Grove: Inter Varsity Press.
  • Prior, Arthur N. (1993). “Changes in Events and Changes in Things,” in Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath: 35-46.
  • Rogers, Katherin A. (1994). “Eternity has no Duration.” Religious Studies 30: 1-16.
  • Rogers, Katherin A. (2000). Perfect Being Theology. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1981). “Eternity,” Journal of Philosophy 78: 429-458. Reprinted in The Concept of God, edited by Thomas V. Morris. New York: Oxford University Press, 1987: 219-252.
  • Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1987). “Atemporal Duration: A Reply to Fitzgerald,” Journal of Philosophy 84: 214-219.
  • Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1991). “Prophecy, Past Truth and Eternity,” Philosophical Perspectives 5 ed., James Tomberlin: 395-424.
  • Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1992). “Eternity, Awareness, and Action,” Faith and Philosophy 9: 463-482.
  • Swinburne, Richard. (1977). The Coherence of Theism. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Swinburne, Richard. (1993). “God and Time,” in Reasoned Faith edited by Eleonore Stump. Ithaca: Cornell University Press: 204-222.
  • Swinburne, Richard. (1994). The Christian God. Oxford: Clarendon.
  • Widerker, David. (1991). “A Problem for the Eternity Solution,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion 29: 87-95.
  • Wierenga, Edward R. (1989). The Nature of God: An Inquiry into Divine Attributes. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Wierenga, Edward R. (1991). “Prophecy, Freedom and the Necessity of the Past,” Philosophical Perspectives 5 ed., James Tomberlin: 425-445.
  • Wierenga, Edward R. (2002). “Timelessness out of Mind,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 153-164.
  • Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (1975). “God Everlasting,” in God and the Good: Essays in Honor of Henry Stob, ed. Clifton Orlebeke and Lewis Smedes. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans. Reprinted in Contemporary Philosophy of Religion, ed. Steven M. Cahn and David Shatz. New York: Oxford University Press, 1982: 77-89.
  • Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (1991). “Divine Simplicity,” Philosophical Perspectives 5: Philosophy of Religion edited by James Tomberlin: 531-552.
  • Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (2001). “Unqualified Divine Temporality,” in Ganssle (2001a): 187-213.

Author Information

Gregory E. Ganssle
Email: gregory.ganssle@yale.edu
Yale University
U. S. A.

Environmental Ethics

The field of environmental ethics concerns human beings’ ethical relationship with the natural environment. While numerous philosophers have written on this topic throughout history, environmental ethics only developed into a specific philosophical discipline in the 1970s. This emergence was no doubt due to the increasing awareness in the 1960s of the effects that technology, industry, economic expansion and population growth were having on the environment. The development of such awareness was aided by the publication of two important books at this time. Rachel Carson’s Silent Spring, first published in 1962, alerted readers to how the widespread use of chemical pesticides was posing a serious threat to public health and leading to the destruction of wildlife. Of similar significance was Paul Ehrlich’s 1968 book, The Population Bomb, which warned of the devastating effects the spiraling human population has on the planet’s resources. Of course, pollution and the depletion of natural resources have not been the only environmental concerns since that time: dwindling plant and animal biodiversity, the loss of wilderness, the degradation of ecosystems, and climate change are all part of a raft of “green” issues that have implanted themselves into both public consciousness and public policy over subsequent years. The job of environmental ethics is to outline our moral obligations in the face of such concerns. In a nutshell, the two fundamental questions that environmental ethics must address are: what duties do humans have with respect to the environment, and why? The latter question usually needs to be considered prior to the former. In order to tackle just what our obligations are, it is usually thought necessary to consider first why we have them. For example, do we have environmental obligations for the sake of human beings living in the world today, for humans living in the future, or for the sake of entities within the environment itself, irrespective of any human benefits? Different philosophers have given quite different answers to this fundamental question which, as we shall see, has led to the emergence of quite different environmental ethics.

Table of Contents

  1. Extending Moral Standing
    1. Human Beings
    2. Sentient Animals
    3. Individual Living Organisms
    4. Holistic Entities
  2. Radical Ecology
    1. Deep Ecology
    2. Social Ecology
    3. Ecofeminism
  3. The Future of Environmental Ethics
  4. References and Further Reading

1. Extending Moral Standing

As noted above, perhaps the most fundamental question that must be asked when regarding a particular environmental ethic is simply, what obligations do we have concerning the natural environment? If the answer is simply that we, as human beings, will perish if we do not constrain our actions towards nature, then that ethic is considered to be “anthropocentric.” Anthropocentrism literally means “human-centeredness,” and in one sense all ethics must be considered anthropocentric. After all, as far as we know, only human beings can reason about and reflect upon ethical matters, thus giving all moral debate a definite “human-centeredness.” However, within environmental ethics anthropocentrism usually means something more than this. It usually refers to an ethical framework that grants “moral standing” solely to human beings. Thus, an anthropocentric ethic claims that only human beings are morally considerable in their own right, meaning that all the direct moral obligations we possess, including those we have with regard to the environment, are owed to our fellow human beings.

While the history of western philosophy is dominated by this kind anthropocentrism, it has come under considerable attack from many environmental ethicists. Such thinkers have claimed that ethics must be extended beyond humanity, and that moral standing should be accorded to the non-human natural world. Some have claimed that this extension should run to sentient animals, others to individual living organisms, and still others to holistic entities such as rivers, species and ecosystems. Under these ethics, we have obligations in respect of the environment because we actually owe things to the creatures or entities within the environment themselves. Determining whether our environmental obligations are founded on anthropocentric or non-anthropocentric reasoning will lead to different accounts of what those obligations are. This section examines the prominent accounts of moral standing within environmental ethics, together with the implications of each.

a. Human Beings

Although many environmental philosophers want to distance themselves from the label of anthropocentrism, it nevertheless remains the case that a number of coherent anthropocentric environmental ethics have been elaborated (Blackstone, 1972; Passmore, 1974; O’Neill, 1997; and Gewirth, 2001). This should be of little surprise, since many of the concerns we have regarding the environment appear to be concerns precisely because of the way they affect human beings. For example, pollution diminishes our health, resource depletion threatens our standards of living, climate change puts our homes at risk, the reduction of biodiversity results in the loss of potential medicines, and the eradication of wilderness means we lose a source of awe and beauty. Quite simply then, an anthropocentric ethic claims that we possess obligations to respect the environment for the sake of human well-being and prosperity.

Despite their human-centeredness, anthropocentric environmental ethics have nevertheless played a part in the extension of moral standing. This extension has not been to the non-human natural world though, but instead to human beings who do not yet exist. The granting of moral standing to future generations has been considered necessary because of the fact that many environmental problems, such as climate change and resource depletion, will affect future humans much more than they affect present ones. Moreover, it is evident that the actions and policies that we as contemporary humans undertake will have a great impact on the well-being of future individuals. In light of these facts, some philosophers have founded their environmental ethics on obligations to these future generations (Gewirth, 2001).

Of course, it is one thing to say that human beings in the future have moral standing, it is quite another to justify the position. Indeed, some philosophers have denied such standing to future people, claiming that they lie outside of our moral community because they cannot act reciprocally (Golding, 1972). So, while we can act so as to benefit them, they can give us nothing in return. This lack of reciprocity, so the argument goes, denies future people moral status. However, other philosophers have pointed to the fact that it is usually considered uncontroversial that we have obligations to the dead, such as executing their wills and so on, even though they cannot reciprocate (Kavka, 1978). While still others have conceded that although any future generation cannot do anything for us, it can nevertheless act for the benefit of its own subsequent generations, thus pointing to the existence of a broader transgenerational reciprocity (Gewirth, 2001).

However, perhaps we do not have obligations to future people because there is no definitive group of individuals to whom such obligations are owed. This argument is not based on the simple fact that future people do not exist yet, but on the fact that we do not know who they will be. Derek Parfit has called this the “non-identity problem” (Parfit, 1984, ch. 16). The heart of this problem lies in the fact that the policies adopted by states directly affect the movement, education, employment and so on of their citizens. Thus, such policies affect who meets whom, and who has children with whom. So, one set of policies will lead to one group of future people, while another set will lead to a different group. Our actions impact who will exist in the future, making our knowledge of who they will be incomprehensible. Since there is no definitive set of future people to receive the benefits or costs of our actions, to whom do we grant moral standing? Secondly, and of particular importance for environmental ethics, how could any future people legitimately complain that they have been wronged by our environmentally destructive policies? For if we had not conducted such policies, they would not even exist.

In response to the non-identity problem, it has been argued that while we do not know exactly who will exist in the future, we do know that some group of people will exist and that they will have interests. In light of this, perhaps our obligations lie with these interests, rather than the future individuals themselves (DesJardins, 2001, p. 74). As for the second aspect of the problem, we might claim that although future generations will benefit from our environmentally destructive policies by their very existence, they will nevertheless have been harmed. After all, cannot one be harmed by a particular action even if one benefits overall? To illustrate this point, James Woodward gives the example of a racist airline refusing to allow a black man on a flight that subsequently crashes (Woodward, 1986). Isn’t this man harmed by the airline, even though he benefits overall?

Even if we do decide to grant moral standing to future human beings, however, that still leaves the problem of deciding just what obligations we have to them. One set of difficulties relates to our ignorance of who they are. For not only do we lack information about the identity of future people, but we have neither knowledge of their conceptions of a good life, nor what technological advances they may have made. For example, why bother preserving rare species of animal or oil reserves if humans in the future receive no satisfaction from the diversity of life and have developed some alternative fuel source? Our ignorance of such matters makes it very difficult to flesh out the content of our obligations.

By way of reply to such problems, some philosophers have argued that while we do not know everything about future people, we can make some reasonable assumptions. For example, Brian Barry has argued that in order to pursue their idea of the good life – whatever that happens to be – future people will have need of some basic resources, such as food, water, minimum health and so on (Barry, 1999). Barry thus argues that our obligations lie with ensuring that we do not prevent future generations from meeting their basic needs. This, in turn, forces us to consider and appropriately revise our levels of pollution, resource depletion, climate change and population growth. While this might seem a rather conservative ethic to some, it is worth pointing out that at no time in humanity’s history have the needs of contemporaries been met, let alone those of future people. This unfortunate fact points to a further problem that all future-oriented anthropocentric environmental ethics must face. Just how are the needs and interests of the current generation to be weighed against the needs and interests of those human beings in the future? Can we justifiably let present people go without for the sake of future humans?

Clearly then, the problems posed by just a minimal extension of moral standing are real and difficult. Despite this, however, most environmental philosophers feel that such anthropocentric ethics do not go far enough, and want to extend moral standing beyond humanity. Only by doing this, such thinkers argue, can we get the beyond narrow and selfish interests of humans, and treat the environment and its inhabitants with the respect they deserve.

b. Animals

If only human beings have moral standing, then it follows that if I come across a bear while out camping and shoot it dead on a whim, I do no wrong to that bear. Of course, an anthropocentric ethic might claim that I do some wrong by shooting the bear dead – perhaps shooting bears is not the action of a virtuous individual, or perhaps I am depleting a source of beauty for most other humans – but because anthropocentrism states that only humans have moral standing, then I can do no wrong to the bear itself. However, many of us have the intuition that this claim is wrong. Many of us feel that it is possible to do wrong to animals, whether that be by shooting innocent bears or by torturing cats. Of course, a feeling or intuition does not get us very far in proving that animals have moral standing. For one thing, some people (hunters and cat-torturers, for example) no doubt have quite different intuitions, leading to quite different conclusions. However, several philosophers have offered sophisticated arguments to support the view that moral standing should be extended to include animals (see Animals and Ethics).

Peter Singer and Tom Regan are the most famous proponents of the view that we should extend moral standing to other species of animal. While both develop quite different animal ethics, their reasons for according moral status to animals are fairly similar. According to Singer, the criterion for moral standing is sentience: the capacity to feel pleasure and pain (Singer, 1974). For Regan, on the other hand, moral standing should be acknowledged in all “subjects-of-a-life”: that is, those beings with beliefs, desires, perception, memory, emotions, a sense of future and the ability to initiate action (Regan, 1983/2004, ch. 7). So, while Regan and Singer give slightly different criteria for moral standing, both place a premium on a form of consciousness.

For Singer, if an entity possesses the relevant type of consciousness, then that entity should be given equal consideration when we formulate our moral obligations. Note that the point is not that every sentient being should be treated equally, but that it should be considered equally. In other words, the differences between individuals, and thus their different interests, should be taken into account. Thus, for Singer it would not be wrong to deny pigs the vote, for obviously pigs have no interest in participating in a democratic society; but it would be wrong to subordinate pigs’ interest in not suffering, for clearly pigs have a strong interest in avoiding pain, just like us. Singer then feeds his principle of equal consideration into a utilitarian ethical framework, whereby the ultimate moral goal is to bring about the greatest possible satisfaction of interests. So there are two strands to Singer’s theory: first of all, we must consider the interests of sentient beings equally; and secondly, our obligations are founded on the aim of bringing about the greatest amount of interest-satisfaction that we can.

Tom Regan takes issue with Singer’s utilitarian ethical framework, and uses the criterion of consciousness to build a “rights-based” theory. For Regan, all entities who are “subjects-of-a-life” possess “inherent value”. This means that such entities have a value of their own, irrespective of their good for other beings or their contribution to some ultimate ethical norm. In effect then, Regan proposes that there are moral limits to what one can do to a subject-of-a-life. This position stands in contrast to Singer who feeds all interests into the utilitarian calculus and bases our moral obligations on what satisfies the greatest number. Thus, in Singer’s view it might be legitimate to sacrifice the interests of certain individuals for the sake of the interest-satisfaction of others. For example, imagine that it is proven that a particular set of painful experiments on half a dozen pigs will lead to the discovery of some new medicine that will itself alleviate the pain of a few dozen human beings (or other sentient animals). If one’s ultimate norm is to satisfy the maximum number of interests, then such experiments should take place. However, for Regan there are moral limits to what one can do to an entity with inherent value, irrespective of these overall consequences. These moral limits are “rights”, and are possessed by all creatures who are subjects-of-a-life.

But what does all this have to do with environmental ethics? Well, in one obvious sense animal welfare is relevant to environmental ethics because animals exist within the natural environment and thus form part of environmentalists’ concerns. However, extending moral standing to animals also leads to the formulation of particular types of environmental obligations. Essentially, these ethics claim that when we consider how our actions impact on the environment, we should not just evaluate how these affect humans (present and/or future), but also how they affect the interests and rights of animals (Singer, 1993, ch. 10, and Regan, 1983/2004, ch. 9). For example, even if clearing an area of forest were proven to be of benefit to humans both in the short and long-term, that would not be the end of the matter as far as animal ethics are concerned. The welfare of the animals residing within and around the forest must also be considered.

However, many environmental philosophers have been dissatisfied with these kinds of animal-centered environmental ethics. Indeed, some have claimed that animal liberation cannot even be considered a legitimate environmental ethic (Callicott, 1980, Sagoff, 1984). For these thinkers, all animal-centered ethics suffer from two fundamental and devastating problems: first of all, they are too narrowly individualistic; and secondly, the logic of animal ethics implies unjustifiable interference with natural processes. As for the first point, it is pointed out that our concerns for the environment extend beyond merely worrying about individual creatures. Rather, for environmentalists, “holistic” entities matter, such as species and ecosystems. Moreover, sometimes the needs of a “whole” clash with the interests of the individuals that comprise it. Indeed, the over-abundance of individuals of a particular species of animal can pose a serious threat to the normal functioning of an ecosystem. For example, many of us will be familiar with the problems rabbits have caused to ecosystems in Australia. Thus, for many environmentalists, we have an obligation to kill these damaging animals. Clearly, this stands opposed to the conclusions of an ethic that gives such weight to the interests and rights of individual animals. The individualistic nature of an animal-centered ethic also means that it faces difficulty in explaining our concern for the plight of endangered species. After all, if individual conscious entities are all that matter morally, then the last surviving panda must be owed just the same as my pet cat. For many environmental philosophers this is simply wrong, and priority must be given to the endangered species (Rolston III, 1985).

Animal-centered ethics also face attack for some of the implications of their arguments. For example, if we have obligations to alleviate the suffering of animals, as these authors suggest, does that mean we must stop predator animals from killing their prey, or partition off prey animals so that they are protected from such attacks (Sagoff, 1984)? Such conclusions not only seem absurd, but also inimical to the environmentalist goal of preserving natural habitats and processes.

Having said all of this, I should not over-emphasize the opposition between animal ethics and environmental ethics. Just because animal ethicists grant moral standing only to conscious individuals, that does not mean that they hold everything else in contempt (Jamieson, 1998). Holistic entities may not have independent moral standing, according to these thinkers, but that does not equate to ignoring them. After all, the welfare and interests of individual entities are often bound up with the healthy functioning of the “wholes” that they make up. Moreover, the idea that animal ethics imply large-scale interferences in the environment can be questioned when one considers how much harm this would inflict upon predator and scavenger animals. Nevertheless, clashes of interest between individual animals and other natural entities are inevitable, and when push comes to shove animal ethicists will invariably grant priority to individual conscious animals. Many environmental ethicists disagree, and are convinced that the boundaries of our ethical concern need to be pushed back further.

c. Individual Living Organisms

As noted above, numerous philosophers have questioned the notion that only conscious beings have moral standing. Some have done this by proposing a thought experiment based on a “last-human scenario” (Attfield, 1983, p. 155). The thought experiment asks us to consider a situation, such as the aftermath of a nuclear holocaust, where the only surviving human being is faced with the only surviving tree of its species. If the individual chops down the tree, no human would be harmed by its destruction. For our purposes we should alter the example and say that all animals have also perished in the holocaust. If this amendment is made, we can go further and say that no conscious being would be harmed by the tree’s destruction. Would this individual be wrong to destroy the tree? According to a human or animal-centered ethic, it is hard to see why such destruction would be wrong. And yet, many of us have the strong intuition that the individual would act wrongly by chopping down the tree. For some environmental philosophers, this intuition suggests that moral standing should be extended beyond conscious life to include individual living organisms, such as trees.

Of course, and as I have mentioned before, we cannot rely only on intuitions to decide who or what has moral standing. For this reason, a number of philosophers have come up with arguments to justify assigning moral standing to individual living organisms. One of the earliest philosophers to put forward such an argument was Albert Schweitzer. Schweitzer’s influential “Reverence for Life” ethic claims that all living things have a “will to live”, and that humans should not interfere with or extinguish this will (Schweitzer, 1923). But while it is clear that living organisms struggle for survival, it is simply not true that they “will” to live. This, after all, would require some kind of conscious experience, which many living things lack. However, perhaps what Schweitzer was getting at was something like Paul W. Taylor’s more recent claim that all living things are “teleological centers of life” (Taylor, 1986). For Taylor, this means that living things have a good of their own that they strive towards, even if they lack awareness of this fact. This good, according to Taylor, is the full development of an organism’s biological powers. In similar arguments to Regan’s, Taylor claims that because living organisms have a good of their own, they have inherent value; that is, value for their own sake, irrespective of their value to other beings. It is this value that grants individual living organisms moral status, and means that we must take the interests and needs of such entities into account when formulating our moral obligations.

But if we recognize moral standing in every living thing, how are we then to formulate any meaningful moral obligations? After all, don’t we as humans require the destruction of many living organisms simply in order to live? For example we need to walk, eat, shelter and clothe ourselves, all of which will usually involve harming living things. Schweitzer’s answer is that we can only harm or end the life of a living entity when absolutely necessary. Of course, this simply begs the question: when is absolutely necessary? Taylor attempts to answer this question by advocating a position of general equality between the interests of living things, together with a series of principles in the event of clashes of interest. First, the principles state that humans are allowed to act in self-defense to prevent harm being inflicted by other living organisms. Second, the basic interests of nonhuman living entities should take priority over the nonbasic or trivial interests of humans. Third, when basic interests clash, humans are not required to sacrifice themselves for the sake of others (Taylor, 1986, pp. 264-304).

As several philosophers have pointed out, however, this ethic is still incredibly demanding. For example, because my interest in having a pretty garden is nonbasic, and a weed’s interest in survival is basic, I am forbidden from pulling it out according to Taylor’s ethical framework. For some, this makes the ethic unreasonably burdensome. No doubt because of these worries, other philosophers who accord moral standing to all living organisms have taken a rather different stance. Instead of adopting an egalitarian position on the interests of living things, they propose a hierarchical framework (Attfield, 1983 and Varner, 1998). Such thinkers point out that moral standing is not the same as moral significance. So while we could acknowledge that plants have moral standing, we might nevertheless accord them a much lower significance than human beings, thus making it easier to justify our use and destruction of them. Nevertheless, several philosophers remain uneasy about the construction of such hierarchies and wonder whether it negates the acknowledgement of moral standing in the first place. After all, if we accept such a hierarchy, just how low is the moral significance of plants? If it is low enough so that I can eat them, weed them and walk on them, what is the point of granting them any moral standing at all?

There remain two crucial challenges facing philosophers who attribute moral standing to individual living organisms that have not yet been addressed. One challenge comes from the anthropocentric thinkers and animal liberationists. They deny that “being alive” is a sufficient condition for the possession of moral standing. For example, while plants may have a biological good, is it really good of their own? Indeed, there seems to be no sense in which something can be said to be good or bad from the point of view of the plant itself. And if the plant doesn’t care about its fate, why should we (Warren, 2000, p. 48)? In response to this challenge, environmental ethicists have pointed out that conscious volition of an object or state is not necessary for that object or state to be a good. For example, consider a cat that needs worming. It is very unlikely that the cat has any understanding of what worming is, or that he needs worming in order to remain healthy and fit. However, it makes perfect sense to say that worming is good for the cat, because it contributes to the cat’s functioning and flourishing. Similarly, plants and tress may not consciously desire sunlight, water or nutrition, but each, according to some ethicists, can be said to be good for them in that they contribute to their biological flourishing.

The second challenge comes from philosophers who question the individualistic nature of these particular ethics. As mentioned above, these critics do not believe that an environmental ethic should place such a high premium on individuals. For many, this individualistic stance negates important ecological commitments to the interdependence of living things, and the harmony to be found in natural processes. Moreover, it is alleged that these individualistic ethics suffer from the same faults as anthropocentric and animal-centered ethics: they simply cannot account for our real and demanding obligations to holistic entities such as species and ecosystems. Once again, however, a word of caution is warranted here. It is not the case that philosophers who ascribe moral standing to individual living things simply ignore the importance of such “wholes”. Often the equilibrium of these entities is taken extremely seriously (See Taylor, 1986, p. 77). However, it must be remembered that such concern is extended only insofar as such equilibrium is necessary in order for individual living organisms to flourish; the wholes themselves have no independent moral standing. In the next section, those philosophers who claim that this standing should be extended to such “wholes” will be examined.

d. Holistic Entities

While Albert Schweitzer can be regarded as the most prominent philosophical influence for thinkers who grant moral standing to all individual living things, Aldo Leopold is undoubtedly the main influence on those who propose “holistic” ethics. Aldo Leopold’s “land ethic” demands that we stop treating the land as a mere object or resource. For Leopold, land is not merely soil. Instead, land is a fountain of energy, flowing through a circuit of soils, plants and animals. While food chains conduct the energy upwards from the soil, death and decay returns the energy back to the soil. Thus, the flow of energy relies on a complex structure of relations between living things. While evolution gradually changes these relations, Leopold argues that man’s interventions have been much more violent and destructive. In order to preserve the relations within the land, Leopold claims that we must move towards a “land ethic”, thereby granting moral standing to the land community itself, not just its individual members. This culminates in Leopold’s famous ethical injunction: “A thing is right when it tends to preserve the integrity, stability, and beauty of the biotic community. It is wrong when it tends otherwise” (Leopold, 1949/1989, pp. 218-225).

Several philosophers, however, have questioned Leopold’s justification of the land ethic. For one thing, it seems that Leopold jumps too quickly from a descriptive account of how the land is, to a prescriptive account of what we ought to do. In other words, even if Leopold’s accounts of the land and its energy flows are correct, why should we preserve it? What precisely is it about the biotic community that makes it deserving of moral standing? Unfortunately, Leopold seems to offer no answers to these important questions, and thus no reason to build our environmental obligations around his land ethic. However, J. Baird Callicott has argued that such criticisms of Leopold are unfair and misplaced. According to Callicott, Leopold lies outside of mainstream moral theory. Rather than assign moral standing on the identification of some particular characteristic, such as consciousness or a biological good of one’s own, Leopold is claimed to accord moral standing on the basis of moral sentiment and affection. Thus, the question is not, what quality does the land possess that makes it worthy of moral standing? But rather, how do we feel about the land (Callicott, 1998)? In this light, the land ethic can be seen as an injunction to broaden our moral sentiments beyond self-interest, and beyond humanity to include the whole biotic community. This, so the argument goes, bridges the gap between the descriptive and the prescriptive in Leopold’s thought.

Of course, some have questioned whether sentiment and feelings are suitable foundations for an environmental ethic. After all, there seem to be plenty of people out there who have no affection for the biotic community whatsoever. If Leopold’s injunction is ignored by such people, must we simply give up hope of formulating any environmental obligations? In the search for more concrete foundations, Lawrence E. Johnson has built an alternative case for according moral standing to holistic entities (Johnson, 1993). Johnson claims that once we recognize that interests are not always tied to conscious experience, the door is opened to the possibility of nonconscious entities having interests and thus moral standing. So, just as breathing oxygen is in the interests of a child, even though the child has neither a conscious desire for oxygen, nor any understanding of what oxygen is, so do species have an interest in fulfilling their nature. This is because both have a good of their own, based on the integrated functioning of their life processes (ibid., p. 142). Children can flourish as living things, and so too can species and ecosystems; so, according to Johnson, both have interests that must be taken into account in our ethical deliberations.

But even if we accept that moral standing should be extended to holistic entities on this basis, we still need to consider how we are then to flesh out our moral obligations concerning the environment. For some, this is where holistic ethics fail to convince. In particular, it has been claimed that holistic ethics condone sacrificing individuals for the sake of the whole. Now while many holistic philosophers do explicitly condone sacrificing individuals in some situations, for example by shooting rabbits to preserve plant species, they are reluctant to sacrifice human interests in similar situations. But isn’t the most abundant species destroying biotic communities Homo sapiens? And if human individuals are just another element within the larger and more important biotic community, is it not necessary under holistic ethics to kill some of these “human pests” for the sake of the larger whole? Such considerations have led Tom Regan to label the implications of holistic ethics as “environmental fascism” (Regan, 1983/2004, p. 362). In response, proponents of such ethics have claimed that acknowledging moral standing in holistic entities does not mean that one must deny the interests and rights of human beings. They claim that granting moral standing to “wholes” is not the same thing as taking it away from individuals. While this is obviously true, that still leaves the question of what to do when the interests of wholes clash with the interests of individuals. If humans cannot be sacrificed for the good of the whole, why can rabbits?

The answer that has been put forward by Callicott claims that while the biotic community matters morally, it is not the only community that matters. Rather, we are part of various “nested” communities all of which have claims upon us. Thus, our obligations to the biotic community may require the culling of rabbits, but may not require the culling of humans. This is because we are part of a tight-knit human community, but only a very loose human-rabbit community. In this way, we can adjudicate clashes of interest, based on our community commitments. This communitarian proposal certainly seems a way out of the dilemma. Unfortunately, it faces two key problems: first, just who decides the content and strength of our various community commitments; and second, if human relationships are the closest, does all this lead back to anthropocentrism? As for the first point, if deciding on our community attachments is left up to individuals themselves, this will lead to quite diverse and even repugnant moral obligations. For example, if an individual believes that he has a much stronger attachment to white males than to black women, does this mean that he can legitimately favor the interests of the former over the latter? If not, and an objective standard is to be imposed, we are left with the enormous problem of discovering this standard and reaching consensus on it. Secondly, if our moral commitments to the biotic community are trumped by our obligations to the human community, doesn’t this lead us back down the path to anthropocentrism – the very thing the holist wants to avoid?

Without doubt, extending moral standing to the degree of holistic ethics requires some extremely careful argumentation when it comes to working out the precise content of our environmental obligations.

2. Radical Ecology

Not all philosophers writing on our obligations concerning the environment see the problem simply in terms of extending moral standing. Instead, many thinkers regard environmental concerns to have warranted an entirely new ideological perspective that has been termed, after its biological counterpart, “ecology”. While the ideas and beliefs within this “radical ecology” movement are diverse, they possess two common elements that separates them from the ethical extensionism outlined above. First of all, none see extending moral standing as sufficient to resolve the environmental crisis. They argue that a broader philosophical perspective is needed, requiring fundamental changes in both our attitude to and understanding of reality. This involves reexamining who we are as human beings and our place within the natural world. For radical ecologists, ethical extensionism is inadequate because it is stuck in the traditional ways of thinking that led to these environmental problems in the first place. In short, it is argued that ethical extensionism remains too human-centered, because it takes human beings as the paradigm examples of entities with moral standing and then extends outwards to those things considered sufficiently similar. Secondly, none of these radical ecologies confine themselves solely to the arena of ethics. Instead, radical ecologies also demand fundamental changes in society and its institutions. In other words, these ideologies have a distinctively political element, requiring us to confront the environmental crisis by changing the very way we live and function, both as a society and as individuals.

a. Deep Ecology

Deep ecology is perhaps most easily understood when considered in opposition to its “shallow” counterpart. According to deep ecologists, shallow ecology is anthropocentric and concerned with pollution and resource depletion. Shallow ecology might thus be regarded as very much the mainstream wing of environmentalism. Deep ecology, in contrast, rejects anthropocentrism and takes a “total-field” perspective. In other words, deep ecologists are not aiming to formulate moral principles concerning the environment to supplement our existing ethical framework. Instead, they demand an entirely new worldview and philosophical perspective. According to Arne Naess, the Norwegian philosopher who first outlined this shallow-deep split in environmentalism, deep ecologists advocate the development of a new eco-philosophy or “ecosophy“ to replace the destructive philosophy of modern industrial society (Naess, 1973). While the various eco-philosophies that have developed within deep ecology are diverse, Naess and George Sessions have compiled a list of eight principles or statements that are basic to deep ecology:

  1. The well-being and flourishing of human and non-human life on Earth have value in themselves (synonyms: intrinsic value, inherent worth). These values are independent of the usefulness of the non-human world for human purposes.
  2. Richness and diversity of life forms contribute to the realization of these values and are also values in themselves.
  3. Humans have no right to reduce this richness and diversity except to satisfy vital needs.
  4. The flourishing of human life and cultures is compatible with a substantially smaller population. The flourishing of non-human life requiresa smaller human population.
  5. Present human interference with the non-human world is excessive, and the situation is rapidly worsening.
  6. Policies must therefore be changed. These policies affect basic economic, technological and ideological structures. The resulting state of affairs will be deeply different from the present.
  7. The ideological change will be mainly that of appreciating life quality (dwelling in situations of inherent value) rather than adhering to an increasingly higher standard of living. There will be a profound awareness of the difference between bigness and greatness.
  8. Those who subscribe to the foregoing points have an obligation directly or indirectly to try to implement the necessary changes (Naess, 1986).

But while Naess regards those who subscribe to these statements as supporters of deep ecology, he does not believe it to follow that all such supporters will have the same worldview or “ecosophy”. In other words deep ecologists do not offer one unified ultimate perspective, but possess various and divergent philosophical and religious allegiances.

Naess’s own ecosophy involves just one fundamental ethical norm: “Self-realization!” For Naess, this norm involves giving up a narrow egoistic conception of the self in favor of a wider more comprehensive Self (hence the deliberate capital “S”). Moving to this wider Self involves recognizing that as human beings we are not removed from nature, but are interconnected with it. Recognizing our wider Self thus involves identifying ourselves with all other life forms on the planet. The Australian philosopher Warwick Fox has taken up this theme of self-realization in his own eco-philosophy, “transpersonal ecology”. Fox does not regard environmental ethics to be predominantly about formulating our moral obligations concerning the environment, but instead views it as about the realization of an “ecological consciousness”. For Fox, as with Naess, this consciousness involves our widest possible identification with the non-human world. The usual ethical concern of formulating principles and obligations thus becomes unnecessary, according to Fox, for once the appropriate consciousness is established, one will naturally protect the environment and allow it to flourish, for that will be part and parcel of the protection and flourishing of oneself (Fox,1990).

Critics of deep ecology argue that it is just too vague to address real environmental concerns. For one thing, in its refusal to reject so many worldviews and philosophical perspectives, many have claimed that it is difficult to uncover just what deep ecology advocates. For example, on the one hand, Naess offers us eight principles that deep ecologists should accept, and on the other he claims that deep ecology is not about drawing up codes of conduct, but adopting a global comprehensive attitude. Now, if establishing principles is important, as so many ethicists believe, perhaps deep ecology requires more precision than can be found in Naess and Sessions’s platform. In particular, just how are we to deal with clashes of interests? According to the third principle, for example, humans have no right to reduce the richness and diversity of the natural world unless to meet vital needs. But does that mean we are under an obligation to protect the richness and diversity of the natural world? If so, perhaps we could cull non-native species such as rabbits when they damage ecosystems. But then, the first principle states that non-human beings such as rabbits have inherent value, and the fifth principle states that human interference in nature is already excessive. So just what should we do? Clearly, the principles as stated by Naess and Sessions are too vague to offer any real guide for action.

However, perhaps principles are not important, as both Naess and Fox have claimed. Instead, they claim that we must rely on the fostering of the appropriate states of consciousness. Unfortunately, two problems remain. First of all, it is not at all clear that all conflicts of interest will be resolved by the adoption of the appropriate state of consciousness. For even if I identify myself with all living things, some of those things, such as bacteria and viruses, may still threaten me as a discrete living organism. And if conflicts of interest remain, don’t we need principles to resolve them? Secondly, and as we saw with Leopold’s land ethic, just what are we to do about those who remain unconvinced about adopting this new state of consciousness? If there aren’t any rational arguments, principles or obligations to point to, what chance is there of persuading such people to take the environmental crisis seriously?

At this point deep ecologists would object that such criticisms remain rooted in the ideology that has caused so much of the crisis we now face. For example, take the point about persuading others. Deep ecologists claim that argument and debate are not the only means we must use to help people realize their ecological consciousness; we must also use such things as poetry, music and art. This relates back to the point I made at the beginning of the section: deep ecologists do not call for supplementary moral principles concerning the environment, but an entirely new worldview. Whether such a radical shift in the way we think about ourselves and the environment is possible, remains to be seen.

b. Social Ecology

Social ecology shares with deep ecology the view that the foundations of the environmental crisis lie in the dominant ideology of modern western societies. Thus, just as with deep ecology, social ecology claims that in order to resolve the crisis, a radical overhaul of this ideology is necessary. However, the new ideology that social ecology proposes is not concerned with the “self-realization” of deep ecology, but instead the absence of domination. Indeed, domination is the key theme in the writings of Murray Bookchin, the most prominent social ecologist. For Bookchin, environmental problems are directly related to social problems. In particular, Bookchin claims that the hierarchies of power prevalent within modern societies have fostered a hierarchical relationship between humans and the natural world (Bookchin, 1982). Indeed, it is the ideology of the free market that has facilitated such hierarchies, reducing both human beings and the natural world to mere commodities. Bookchin argues that the liberation of both humans and nature are actually dependent on one another. Thus his argument is quite different from Marxist thought, in which man’s freedom is dependent on the complete domination of the natural world through technology. For Bookchin and other social ecologists, this Marxist thinking involves the same fragmentation of humans from nature that is prevalent in capitalist ideology. Instead, it is argued that humans must recognize that they are part of nature, not distinct or separate from it. In turn then, human societies and human relations with nature can be informed by the non-hierarchical relations found within the natural world. For example, Bookchin points out that within an ecosystem, there is no species more important than another, instead relationships are mutualistic and interrelated. This interdependence and lack of hierarchy in nature, it is claimed, provides a blueprint for a non-hierarchical human society (Bookchin, 2001).

Without doubt, the transformation that Bookchin calls for is radical. But just what will this new non-hierarchical, interrelated and mutualistic human society look like? For Bookchin, an all powerful centralized state is just another agent for domination. Thus in order to truly be rid of hierarchy, the transformation must take place within smaller local communities. Such communities will be based on sustainable agriculture, participation through democracy, and of course freedom through non-domination. Not only then does nature help cement richer and more equal human communities, but transformed societies also foster a more benign relationship with nature. This latter point illustrates Bookchin’s optimistic view of humanity’s potential. After all, Bookchin does not think that we should condemn all of humanity for causing the ecological crisis, for instead it is the relationships within societies that are to blame (Bookchin, 1991). Because of this, Bookchin is extremely critical of the anti-humanism and misanthropy he perceives to be prevalent in much deep ecology.

One problem that has been identified with Bookchin’s social ecology is his extrapolation from the natural world to human society. Bookchin argues that the interdependence and lack of hierarchy within nature provides a grounding for non-hierarchical human societies. However, as we saw when discussing Aldo Leopold, it is one thing to say how nature is, but quite another to say how society ought to be. Even if we accept that there are no natural hierarchies within nature (which for many is dubious), there are plenty of other aspects of it that most of us would not want to foster in our human society. For example, weak individuals and weak species are often killed, eaten and out-competed in an ecosystem. This, of course, is perfectly natural and even fits in with ecology’s characterization of nature as interconnected. However, should this ground human societies in which the weak are killed, eaten and out-competed? Most of us find such a suggestion repugnant. Following this type of reasoning, many thinkers have warned of the dangers of drawing inferences about how society should be organized from certain facts about how nature is (Dobson, 1995, p. 42).

Some environmental philosophers have also pointed to a second problem with Bookchin’s theory. For many, his social ecology is anthropocentric, thus failing to grant the environment the standing it deserves. Critics cite evidence of anthropocentrism in the way Bookchin accounts for the liberation of both humans and nature. This unfolding process will not just occur of its own accord, according to Bookchin, rather, human beings must facilitate it. Of course, many philosophers are extremely skeptical of the very idea that history is inevitably “unfolding” towards some particular direction. However, some environmental philosophers are more wary of the prominent place that Bookchin gives to human beings in facilitating this unfolding. Of course, to what extent this is a problem depends on one’s point of view. After all, if humans cannot ameliorate the environmental problems we face, is there much point doing environmental ethics in the first place? Indeed, Bookchin himself has been rather nonplussed by this charge, and explicitly denies that humans are just another community in nature. But he also denies that nature exists solely for the purposes of humans. However, the critics remain unconvinced, and believe it to be extremely arrogant to think that humans know what the unfolding of nature will look like, let alone to think that they can bring it about (Eckersley, 1992, pp. 154-156).

c. Ecofeminism

Like social ecology, ecofeminism also points to a link between social domination and the domination of the natural world. And like both deep ecology and social ecology, ecofeminism calls for a radical overhaul of the prevailing philosophical perspective and ideology of western society. However, ecofeminism is a broad church, and there are actually a number of different positions that feminist writers on the environment have taken. In this section I will review three of the most prominent.

Val Plumwood offers a critique of the rationalism inherent in traditional ethics and blames this rationalism for the oppression of both women and nature. The fundamental problem with rationalism, so Plumwood claims, is its fostering of dualisms. For example, reason itself is usually presented in stark opposition to emotion. Traditional ethics, Plumwood argues, promote reason as capable of providing a stable foundation for moral argument, because of its impartiality and universalizability. Emotion, on the other hand, lacks these characteristics, and because it is based on sentiment and affection makes for shaky ethical frameworks. Plumwood claims that this dualism between reason and emotion grounds other dualisms in rationalist thought: in particular, mind/body, human/nature and man/woman. In each case, the former is held to be superior to the latter (Plumwood, 1991). So, for Plumwood, the inferiority of both women and nature have a common source: namely, rationalism. Once this is recognized, so the argument goes, it becomes clear that simple ethical extensionism as outlined above is insufficient to resolve the domination of women and nature. After all, such extensionism is stuck in the same mainstream rationalist thought that is the very source of the problem. What is needed instead, according to Plumwood, is a challenge to rationalism itself, and thus a challenge to the dualisms it perpetuates.

However, while it is perfectly possible to acknowledge the rationalism present in much mainstream ethical thinking, one can nevertheless query Plumwood’s characterization of it. After all, does rationalism necessarily

promote dualisms that are responsible for the subjugation of women and nature? Such a claim would seem odd given the many rationalist arguments that have been put forward to promote the rights and interests of both women and the natural world. In addition, many thinkers would argue that rationalist thought is not the enemy, but instead the best hope for securing proper concern for the environment and for women. For as we have seen above, such thinkers believe that relying on the sentiments and feelings of individuals is too unstable a foundation upon which to ground a meaningful ethical framework.

Karen J. Warren has argued that the dualisms of rationalist thought, as outlined by Plumwood, are not in themselves problematic. Rather, Warren claims that they become problematic when they are used in conjunction with an “oppressive conceptual framework” to justifysubordination. Warren argues that one feature inherent within an oppressive conceptual framework is the “logic of domination”. Thus, a list of the differences between humans and nature, and between men and women, is not in itself harmful. But once assumptions are added, such as these differences leading to the moral superiority

of humans and of men, then we move closer to the claim that we are justified in subordinating women and nature on the basis of their inferiority. According to Warren, just such a logic of domination has been prevalent within western society. Men have been identified with the realm of the “mental” and “human”, while women have been identified with the “physical” and the “natural”. Once it is claimed that the “natural” and the “physical” are morally inferior to the “human” and “mental”, men become justified in subordinating women and nature. For Warren then, feminists and environmentalists share the same goal: namely, to abolish this oppressive conceptual framework (Warren, 1990).

Other ecofeminists take a quite different approach to Plumwood and Warren. Rather than outlining the connections between the domination

of women and of nature, they instead emphasize those things that link women and the natural world. Women, so the argument goes, stand in a much closer relationship to the natural world due to their capacity for child-bearing. For some ecofeminists, this gives women a unique perspective on how to build harmonious relationships with the natural world. Indeed, many such thinkers advocate a spiritualist approach in which nature and the land are given a sacred value, harking back to ancient religions in which the Earth is considered female (Mies & Shiva, 1993).

For writers such as Plumwood, however, emphasizing women’s “naturalness” in this way simply reinforces the dualism that led to women’s oppression in the first place. Placing women as closer to nature, according to Plumwood, simply places them closer to oppression. Other critics argue that the adoption of a spiritualist approach leads feminists to turn their attention inwards to themselves and their souls, and away from those individuals and entities they should be trying to liberate. However, in response, these ecofeminists may make the same point as the deep ecologists: to resolve the environmental problems we face, and the systems of domination in place, it is the consciousness and philosophical outlook of individuals that must change.

3. The Future of Environmental Ethics

Given the increasing concern for the environment and the impact that our actions have upon it, it is clear that the field of environmental ethics is here to stay.

However, it is less clear in what way the discipline will move forward. Having said that,

there is evidence for at least three future developments. First of all, environmental ethics needs to be and will be informed by changes in the political efforts to ameliorate environmental problems. Environmental ethics concerns formulating our moral obligations regarding the environment. While this enterprise can be, and often is, quite abstract, it is also meant to engage with the real world. After all, ethicists are making claims about how they think the world ought to be. Given this, the effectiveness of states and governments in “getting there” will affect the types of ethics that emerge. For example, the Kyoto Protocol might be regarded as the first real global attempt to deal with the problem of climate change. However, without the participation of so many large polluters, with the agreed reductions in greenhouse gas emissions so small, and with many countries looking like they may well miss their targets, many commentators already regard it as a failure. Ethicists need to respond not just by castigating those they blame for the failure. Rather they must propose alternative and better means of resolving the problems we face. For example, is it more important to outline a scheme of obligations for individuals

rather than states, and go for a bottom-up solution to these problems? Alternatively, perhaps businesses

should take the lead in tackling these problems. Indeed, it may even be in the interests of big business to be active in this way, given the power of consumers. It is quite possible then, that we will see business ethics address many of the same issues that environmental ethics has been tackling.

However, the effects of environmental ethics will not be limited to influencing and informing business ethics alone, but will undoubtedly feed into and merge with more mainstream ethical thinking.

After all, the environment is not something one can remove oneself from. In light of this, once it is recognized that we have environmental obligations, all areas of ethics are affected, including just war theory, domestic distributive justice, global distributive justice, human rights theory and many others. Take global distributive justice as an example: if one considers how climate change will affect people throughout the world so differently – affecting individuals’ homes, sanitation, resistance from disease, ability to earn a living and so on – it is clear that consideration of the environment is essential to such questions of justice. Part of the job of the environmental ethicist will thus be to give such disciplines the benefit of his or her expertise.

Finally, environmental ethics will of course be informed by our scientific understanding of the environment. Whether it be changes in our understanding of how ecosystems work, or changes in the evidence concerning the environmental crisis, it is clear that such change will inform and influence those thinkers writing on our environmental obligations.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Attfield, Robin, The Ethics of Environmental Concern (Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1983).
  • Barry, Brian, “Sustainability and Intergenerational Justice” in Dobson, Andrew (ed.), Fairness and Futurity (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999): 93-117.
  • Benson, John, Environmental Ethics: An Introduction with Readings (London: Routledge, 2001).
  • Blackstone, William T., “Ethics and Ecology” in Blackstone, William T. (ed.), Philosophy and Environmental Crisis (Athens, University of Georgia Press, 1972): 16-42.
  • Bookchin, Murray, The Ecology of Freedom: The Emergence and Dissolution of Hierarchy (Palo Alto, CA: Cheshire Books, 1982).
  • Bookchin, Murray, “What is Social Ecology?” in, Boylan, Michael (ed.), Environmental Ethics (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2001): 62-76.
  • Bookchin, Murray and Foreman, Dave, Defending the Earth (New York: Black Rose Books, 1991).
  • Boylan, Michael (ed.), Environmental Ethics (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2001).
  • Brennan, Andrew and Lo, Yeuk-Sze, “Environmental Ethics”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2002 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), http://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2002/entries/ethics-environmental.
  • Callicott, James Baird, “Animal Liberation: A Triangular Affair”, Environmental Ethics 2 (1980): 311-328.
  • Callicott, James Baird, “The Conceptual Foundations of the Land Ethic” in Zimmerman, Michael E.; Callicott, J. Baird; Sessions, George; Warren, Karen J.; and Clark, John (eds.), Environmental Philosophy: From Animal Rights to Radical Ecology (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2nd ed., 1998): 101-123.
  • Carson, Rachel, Silent Spring (Boston: Houghton Mifflin, 1962).
  • DesJardins, Joseph R., Environmental Ethics: An Introduction to Environmental Philosophy (Belmont CA: Wadsworth, 3rd ed., 2001).
  • Dobson, Andrew, Green Political Thought (London: Routledge, 2nd ed., 1995).
  • Eckersely, Robyn, Environmentalism and Political Theory: Toward an Ecocentric Approach (London: UCL Press, 1992).
  • Ehrlich, Paul, The Population Bomb (New York: Ballantine Books, 1968).
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Author Information

Alasdair Cochrane
Email: A.D.Cochrane@lse.ac.uk
London School of Economics and Political Science
United Kingdom

Process Philosophy

Process philosophy is a longstanding philosophical tradition that emphasizes becoming and changing over static being. Though present in many historical and cultural periods, the term “process philosophy” is primarily associated with the work of the philosophers Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000).

Process philosophy is characterized by an attempt to reconcile the diverse intuitions found in human experience (such as religious, scientific, and aesthetic) into a coherent holistic scheme. Process philosophy seeks a return to a neo-classical realism that avoids subjectivism. This reconciliation of the intuitions of objectivity and subjectivity, with a concern for scientific findings, produces the explicitly metaphysical speculation that the world, at its most fundamental level, is made up of momentary events of experience rather than enduring material substances. Process philosophy speculates that these momentary events, called “actual occasions” or “actual entities,” are essentially self-determining, experiential, and internally related to each other.

Actual occasions correspond to electrons and sub-atomic particles, but also to human persons. The human person is a society of billions of these occasions (that is, the body), which is organized and coordinated by a single dominant occasion (that is, the mind). Thus, process philosophy avoids a strict mind-body dualism.

Most process philosophers speculate that God is also an actual entity, though there is an internal debate among process thinkers whether God is a series of momentary actual occasions, like other worldly societies, or a single everlasting and constantly developing actual entity. Either way, process philosophy conceives of God as dipolar. God’s primordial nature is the permanent ground of value and determinacy and a storehouse for universals, or “envisaged potentialities.” God’s consequent nature, on the other hand, takes in data from the world at every instant, changing as the world changes. A considerable number of process philosophers argue that God is not a necessary element of the metaphysical system and may be excised from the process model without any loss of consistency.

Process philosophy has also been cited as a unique synthesis of classical methodology, modern concerns for scientific adequacy, and post-modern critiques of hegemony, dualism, determinism, materialism, and egocentrism. In this respect, process philosophy is sometimes called “constructive postmodernism,” alluding to its speculative method of system building with a hypothetical and fallible stance, over the alternative of deconstruction.

Table of Contents

  1. What Counts as Process Philosophy
    1. The Perennial Process Tradition
    2. The Whitehead-Hartshorne Tradition
  2. Assumptions and Method
    1. In Pursuit of a Holistic Worldview
    2. Neo-Classical Realism
    3. Speculative Metaphysics
  3. Basic Metaphysics
    1. Creativity as Ultimate
    2. Events, not Substances
    3. Internal and External Relations
    4. Rejection of Nominalism
  4. The Human Person
    1. Panexperientialism with Organizational Duality
    2. Perception and Prehension
  5. God and the World
    1. Dipolar Panentheism
    2. Freedom and the Problem of Evil
  6. Non-theistic Variations
  7. Process Philosophy as Constructive Postmodernism
  8. Conclusion
  9. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. What Counts as Process Philosophy

a. The Perennial Process Tradition

Process philosophy argues that the language of development and change are more appropriate descriptors of reality than the language of static being. This tradition has roots in the West in the pre-Socratic Heraclitus, who likened the structure of reality to the element of fire, as change is reality and stability is illusion. Heraclitus is famous for the aphorism that one can never step in the same river twice.

In Eastern traditions, many Taoist and Buddhist doctrines can be classified as “process.” For example, the Taoist admonition that one should be spontaneously receptive to the never ending flux of yin and yang emphasizes a process worldview, as do the Buddhist notions of pratyitya-samutpada (the inter-dependent origination of events) and anatma (the denial of a substantial or enduring self).

More recently on the continent, one finds process philosophers in Hegel, who saw the history of the world as processive and dialectic unfolding of Absolute Spirit and in Gottfried Leibniz, Henri Bergson, Nikolai Berdyaev, Friedrich Nietzsche, and Pierre Teilhard de Chardin. Even David Hume (insofar as he rejected the idea of a substantial self in favor of a series of unconnected perceptual “bundles”) can be considered a process philosopher.

Process Philosophy found its most fertile ground and active development in 20th century North America. American philosophers Samuel Alexander, George Herbert Mead, John Dewey, C.S. Peirce, William James, Alfred North Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne, and others continue this tradition.

Peirce’s philosophy is process-oriented in several respects. He defines truth as the unattainable goal of a never-ending process of inquiry. Likewise, Peirce’s semiology indicates that the meaning of signs is always triangulated between an object, its sign, and the infinite series of “interpretants” or subjective impressions made by the sign upon human knowers. Thus, Peirce correlates meaning with an ongoing and indeterminate historical process interpretation. Finally, Peirce was a staunch anti-determinist and advocated tychism, the belief that the operations of the natural world were not fixed and regular, but exhibit considerable spontaneity.

James is considered a process philosopher for several reasons. He stresses that true empiricism requires that we acknowledge the continuous flow of experience (the “blooming buzzing confusion”) as our primary datum rather than individual and discrete physical objects. Also, James was a strong proponent of libertarianism (the belief in genuinely free choice, not the political ideology) and argued that determinism was not a genuine candidate for belief. James also advocated a metaphysics of “pure experience” late in his career, which puts forth the hypothesis that both mind and matter are manifestations of a more primary experiential “stuff.”

Dewey exhibited process themes in his philosophy of education and epistemology. First, Dewey’s philosophy of education criticized the rote memorization of facts, and advocated the development of critical thinking faculties and problem solving abilities, thus shifting the emphasis from the accumulation of static propositions to building capacities for appropriating new insight. Likewise, Dewey’s epistemology of transaction argues that no belief should be considered final, as human knowledge is in a constant state of revision and development. Likewise, the naming of objects is always tentative and human knowing cannot be divorced from its temporal context.

b. The Whitehead-Hartshorne Tradition

Despite these rich and varied contributions, the term “process philosophy” (as well as “process theology” and “process thought”) has become virtually synonymous with the neo-naturalist philosophical legacy left by Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000). This association was popularized among those theologians and philosophers of the mid-century “Chicago School.” For this reason, the remainder of this essay will primarily focus on the Whiteheadian-Hartshornean school of process philosophy. Contemporary philosophers in this school include Lewis Ford, David Ray Griffin, Robert Neville, Victor Lowe, Donald Sherburne, Donald Wayne Viney, Jude Jones, John Lango, Daniel Dombrowski, Randall Auxier, and C. Robert Mesle, among others. Notable characteristics of this variant of process philosophy are its (1) method of metaphysical speculation, (2) event (rather than substance) ontology, (3) assertion of panpsychism or panexperientialism, (4) description of “prehension” in place of perception, and (5) panentheist doctrine of God.

2. Assumptions and Method

a. In Pursuit of a Holistic Worldview

Whitehead begins the preface to his Science and the Modern World (1925) by noting that the human intuitions of science, aesthetics, ethics, and religion each make a positive contribution to the worldview of a community. In each historical period, any one or combination of these intuitions may receive emphasis and thus influence the dominant worldview of its people. It is a peculiar characteristic of the last three (now four) centuries that scientific pursuits have come to dominate the worldview of Western minds. For this reason, Whitehead seeks to establish a comprehensive cosmology—understood here in the sense of a systematic descriptive theory of the world—that does justice to all of the human intuitions and not only the scientific ones. Toward this end, Whitehead argues that philosophy is the “critic of cosmologies,” whose job it is to synthesize, scrutinize and make coherent the divergent intuitions gained through ethical, aesthetic, religious, and scientific experience. Process philosophy is frequently used as a conceptual bridge to facilitate discussions between religion, philosophy, and science.

b. Neo-Classical Realism

Process philosophy represents an aberration in the history of philosophy, as it rejects the peculiarly Modern practice of beginning with philosophical analysis of the knowing subject and moving outwards toward descriptions of the world. Since Rene Descartes, epistemology (the investigation of the origin, structure, methods and validity of knowledge) has been primary and foundational, while ontology (the study of fundamental principles of being) has been secondary and only attempted once its possibility has been established by epistemological analysis.

Process philosophers, however, tend to embrace the reverse, which was more common in classical Greek philosophy. Rather than beginning with subjectivity, process philosophy seeks to describe the world first and the subject’s place in it second. Hartshorne adopted the descriptor “neoclassical” to describe his philosophy and especially his doctrine of God. Hartshorne was neoclassical not only because his philosophy was theocentric rather than egocentric, but also because of his strong tendencies toward rationalism. (Hartshorne defended a variety of the ontological argument for the existence of God.) This neoclassical realist approach circumvents philosophical attacks on metaphysics (for example, Kant’s transcendental critique) that arose in the Modern period. It is a matter of debate between process philosophers and their critics, however, whether process philosophy is pre-modern or post-modern in this respect.

c. Speculative Metaphysics

Process philosophy as a whole employs three methodologies, usually simultaneously: empiricism (knowledge from experience), rationalism (knowledge from deduction), and speculation (knowledge from imagination). Whitehead’s famous metaphor for philosophy from the opening pages of his opus Process and Reality (1929) is that of a short airplane flight. Philosophy begins on the ground with the concrete reality of lived experience. Experience provides us with the raw data for our theories. Then, our thought takes off, losing contact with the ground and soaring into heights of imaginative speculation. During speculation, we use rational criteria and imagination to synthesize facts into a (relatively) systematic worldview. In the end, however, our theories must eventually land and once again make contact with the ground—our speculations and hypotheses must ultimately answer once again to the authority of experience. Though one of Whitehead’s more infamous aphorisms is that “it is more important that an idea be interesting than true,” he insists that speculative theories be both coherent and adequate to the facts of experience. By taking this airplane flight as a model for speculative metaphysics, Whitehead envisions the process of metaphysics to consist in an unending series of “test flights,” as our metaphysical conclusions are never final and always hypothetical. The process of adjusting our metaphysics to meet the demands of experience is a task with no end in sight, as experience continually provides the philosopher with new facts. Thus, process metaphysics regards the status of its own claims as contingent and tentative. This differs significantly from classical metaphysical systems, which are regarded as final, authoritative, and necessary.

3. Basic Metaphysics

a. Creativity as Ultimate

Whitehead argues that the best description of ultimate reality is through the principle of creativity. Creativity is the universal of universals—that which is only actual in virtue of its accidents or instances. Thus, creativity is frequently compared to the notions of Aristotle’s “being qua being,” Martin Heidegger’s “Being itself” (more appropriately “Becoming itself”), or even the material cause of all events. Creativity is the most general notion at the base of all that actually exists. Thus, all actual entities, even God, are in a sense “creatures” of creativity.

Whitehead also characterizes creativity as the principle of novelty. The events of the past are ceaselessly synthesized into a new and unique event, which becomes data for future events. “The many become one, and are increased by one,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 20). This focus on oscillation between one and many forms the foundation of the process metaphysic.

b. Events, not Substances

The most counter-intuitive doctrine of process philosophy is its sharp break from the Aristotelian metaphysics of substance, that actuality is not made up of inert substances that are extended in space and time and only externally related to each other. Process thought instead states that actuality is made up of atomic or momentary events. These events, called actual entities or actual occasions, are “the final real things of which the world is made up,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 18). They occur very briefly and are characterized by the power of self-determination and subjective immediacy (though not necessarily conscious experience). In many ways, actual occasions are similar to Leibniz’s monads [link], except that occasions are internally related to each other.

The enduring objects one perceives with the senses (for example, rocks, trees, persons, etc.) are made up of serially ordered “societies,” or strings of momentary actual occasions, each flowing into the next and giving the illusion of an object that is continuously extended in time, much like the rapid succession of individual frames in a film that appear as a continuous picture. Contemporary commentators on process thought suggest that individual actual occasions vary in spatio-temporal “size” and can correspond to the phenomena of sub-atomic particles, atoms, molecules, cells, and human persons (that is, souls). Likewise, these individuals may aggregate together to form larger societies (for example, rocks, trees, animal bodies). According to this model, a single electron would be a series of momentary electron-occasions. Likewise, the human subject would be a series of single occasions that coordinates and organizes many of the billions of other actual occasions that make up the subject’s “physical” body.

Where substance metaphysics and modern science have posited that the world is made up of material objects, Whitehead argues that “organism” is a better term for things that exist. Whereas matter is self-sustaining, externally related, valueless, passive, and without an intrinsic principle of motion; organisms are interdependent, internally and externally related, value-laden, active, and intrinsically active.

c. Internal and External Relations

Process philosophy rejects the doctrine of scientific materialism and substance-based metaphysics that entities can only influence each other by means of external relations. In a metaphysic of material substance, solid bodies are only able to influence other solid bodies by making physical contact with them or exerting some force on them. Although these interaction produce change, they do not affect the intrinsic constitution of the bodies acted upon. As a result, the actualities of materialist metaphysics are able to endure interaction without any changes to their constitution.

Process philosophy asserts that actual occasions influence each other by internal and external relations. When one actual occasion is internally related to another, the past occasions participate in and contribute to the intrinsic character of the present. The primary vehicle for internal relatedness is Whitehead’s notion of prehension. Prehension is the experiential activity of an actual occasion by which characteristics of one occasion come to be present in another. Thus, one occasion may prehend certain qualities of an occasion in its past (for example, a shade of red or a certain proposition). By means of prehension, a past occasion comes to be constitutively present in the contemporary occasion and contributes to its intrinsic character. All actualities prehend. This is not a voluntary or a necessarily conscious activity.

One important consequence of this doctrine is the principle of relativity, which states that every actual occasion is internally related to every other actual occasion in its past (that is, the entire past history of the universe), though the efficacy each past occasion exerts upon the present occasion may vary widely. Thus process philosophers describe the world as a vast and tangled web of relationalty and interdependence.

d. Rejection of Nominalism

Whitehead, who famously asserts that the history of philosophy is safely characterized as “a series of footnotes to Plato” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 39), resurrects the Platonic notion that the qualities of objects exist independently of any perceiver. This position arises from the need for the actual occasions to take on “forms of definiteness” as they assimilate the data of the past into the particularity of the present. Because Whitehead argues that anything that exerts causal efficacy upon the world must be an actual entity (his “ontological principle”), he denies that universals are free-floating, independently real entities like the Platonic Forms. Instead, Whitehead calls the universals “eternal objects” and locates them in the mind of God, who is an actual entity. The divine actuality, according to Whitehead, primordially envisages and orders the eternal objects into an ideal pattern(s). Eternal objects are tiered in complexity. Several simple eternal objects can be ordered into a single complex eternal object, which would be an ordered arrangement of simpler eternal objects. So a particular shade of green is a relatively simple eternal object, while “green life form” is a more complex eternal object and “vegetable” would be even more complex.

Thus, eternal objects are relevant novel possibilities that are presented to and “ingress” into every actual occasion. The divine actuality mediates eternal objects—both simple and complex—to other actual occasions by means of prehension. These eternal objects make their way into the concrescing (developing) actual occasions when an occasion “feels” them in a past actual occasion or in the divine actuality. A person who experiences a musty smell feels that datum as a complex eternal object that was present in the occasions that make up the moldy book. The direct transmission of eternal objects from the divine actuality to worldly actual occasions is the chief source of novelty in the world.

Though Whitehead and Hartshorne share many metaphysical commitments, Whitehead’s doctrine of eternal objects is one source of significant disagreement between the two process philosophers. Hartshorne argues that although there is a meaningful sense in which specific qualities of phenomena are objectively real, he does not agree that they are “haunting reality from all eternity, as it were, begging for instantiation, nor that God primordially envisages a complete set of such qualities,” (Hartshorne, Creative Synthesis, 59). For example, Hartshorne uses the example that the quality of “being like Shakespeare” could not have existed, even in God’s mind, before Shakespeare’s actual existence.

Hartshorne contends that Whitehead has obscured or overlooked the distinction between what is determinable and what is determinate. The former consists in unactualized possibility that is in no way settled beforehand. Hartshorne asks us to consider the advance possibilities of a painter creating a painting. Certainly the possible outcomes are partially definite. There are only so many pigments in existence and the perceptual range of human vision is fixed, but the precise outcome of this creative act is not pre-existent as an eternal object. Not even God, claims Hartshorne, can anticipate the products of human creativity. Prior to completion, the finished painting is determinable, but not determinate. The process of becoming for Hartshorne is more than the temporally ordered actualization of antecedently (or eternally) present forms—a “vast sum of determinates”—but rather the essentially creative emergence of genuinely novel forms and patterns of infinite range.

Hartshorne, however, does not endorse nominalism, which he defines as the denial of a genuine distinction between the universal and the particular. (Nominalists either deny ontological status to all universals or to all particulars.) In this sense, Hartshorne is a realist, just not as robustly realist as Whitehead. He allows that some universals are eternal (for example, the necessary aspect of deity and numbers), but most are emergent and contingent upon the temporal flow of actual events.

4. The Human Person

a. Panexperientialism with Organizational Duality

Process metaphysics doctrine of panpsychism or panexperientialism state that all individual actual entities—from electrons to human persons—are essentially self-determining and possess the ability to experience the world around them. Although actual entities possess experience, it is not necessarily conscious experience. Whitehead argues that consciousness presupposes experience and not vice versa.

Panexperientialism is another significant departure from the dominant metaphysical theories of idealism (all is mind), dualism (mind and matter are equally fundamental), or materialism (all is matter). Whitehead’s metaphysic is a monistic one. Everything that is actual is composed of actual occasions. Actual occasions are themselves diverse; they vary in size and complexity. Electronic occasions have limited freedom and opportunities, while human persons are capable of incredibly rich experiences. Despite the great range of complexity, these differences are differences of degree, not of kind. Thus, the traditional problems of mind-body interaction are not present in process metaphysics because reality, at its base, is not purely mental or physical. Actual entities, as events, are at their foundation experiential and one can have physical experiences and mental experiences.

Although the system is a monistic one, which is characterized by experience going “all the way down” to the simplest and most basic actualities, there is a duality between the types of organizational patterns to which societies of actual occasions might conform. In some instances, actual occasions will come together and give rise to a “regnant” or dominant society of occasions. The most obvious example of this is when the molecule-occasions and cell-occasions in a body produce, by means of a central nervous system, a mind or soul. This mind or soul prehends all the feeling and experience of the billions of other bodily occasions and coordinates and integrates them into higher and more complex forms of experience. The entire society that supports and includes a dominant member is, to use Hartshorne’s term, a compound individual.

Other times, however, a bodily society of occasions lacks a dominant member to organize and integrate the experiences of others. Rocks, trees, and other non-sentient objects are examples of these aggregate or corpuscular societies. In this case, the diverse experiences of the multitude of actual occasions conflict, compete, and are for the most part lost and cancel each other out. Whereas the society of occasions that comprises a compound individual is a monarchy, Whitehead describes corpuscular societies as “democracies.” This duality accounts for how, at the macroscopic phenomenal level, we experience a duality between the mental and physical despite the fundamentally and uniformly experiential nature of reality. Those things that seem to be purely physical are corpuscular societies of occasions, while those objects that seem to possess consciousness, intelligence, or subjectivity are compound individuals.

b. Perception and Prehension

Every actual occasion receives data from every other actual occasion in its past by means of prehension. Whitehead calls the process of integrating this data by proceeding from indeterminacy to determinacy “concrescence.” Concrescence typically consists of an occasion feeling the entirety of its past actual world, filtering and selecting some data for relevance, and integrating, combining, and contrasting that original data with novel data (provided by the divine occasion) in increasingly complex stages of “feeling” until the occasion reaches “satisfaction” and has become fully actual. Because this process of synthesis involves distilling the entire past universe down into a single moment of particular experience, Whitehead calls a completed actual occasion “superject” or “subject-superject.” After an occasion reaches satisfaction, it becomes an objectively immortal datum for all future occasions.

In human beings (and all other sufficiently complex animals), the concrescing structure of the dominant occasions entails that consciousness is a derivative form of experience that only appears in the latest stage of concrescence. “Consciousness flickers; and even at its brightest, there is a small focal region of clear illumination, and a large penumbral region of experience which tells of intense experience in dim apprehension. The simplicity of clear consciousness is no measure of the complexity of complete experience,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 267). Thus, sense perception, because it is conscious, is considered by Whitehead to be a relatively superficial mode of perception. In fact, Whitehead argues that human beings perceive in three modes, of which sensory perception is only one.

Perception in the mode of causal efficacy is Whitehead’s term for the initial prehension by an actual occasion of its entire past world. Whitehead describes the data of the past world coming to bear upon the occasion as “brute fact.” Thus, the occasions of the past exert efficient causation upon the concrescing occasion. Whitehead argues that all actualities experience perception in the mode of causal efficacy, and it is by far the most significant and fundamental mode of causation. Thus, contrary to Hume, we do perceive the causal influence of other actualities, although not always consciously.

Perception in the mode of presentational immediacy is the manifestation of causal efficacy as it “bubbles up” into consciousness. Some examples include uninterpreted blotches of color that one sees or the experience of an audible tone, without comparison to those tones that have already been heard. Presentational immediacy provides the subject with information about the durational present, but not the past or future.

These two “pure” modes of perception—causal efficacy and perceptual immediacy—are combined in the third “impure” mode of perception: symbolic reference. Perception in the mode of symbolic reference is the process by which we identify and correlate those phenomena in causal efficacy with the causally efficacious occasions in our past. Symbolic reference is the conscious (or liminally conscious) activity of assigning referential relations between immediate sensory phenomena and past actualities “out there” in the world. Process philosophy diverges from the skepticism about the world-in-itself engendered by Hume and Imannuel Kant. Human beings are able to perceive causal relations and can correlate noumena and phenomena by means of symbolic reference.

5. God and the World

a. Dipolar Panentheism

In his metaphysical works, Whitehead notes that, given the virtually unlimited number of “forms of definiteness” (that is, eternal objects) available, the “creative advance” of the occasions in the universe would not be possible if there were not some “principle of concretion or limitation” placed upon actuality. This principle must determine which forms are available for instantiation in each object and introduce contraries, grades, and oppositions among those values. The metaphysical system requires a reason that actual occasions take on only a very specific selection of the eternal objects that are available. Thus, God is introduced into the system as the principle of limitation, which actual occasions require. In Whitehead’s system, only actual entities can have causal efficacy. Thus, a divine actual entity was posited. Though Whitehead’s philosophy has inspired an entire tradition of process theology, the doctrine of God at this point (especially in Science and the Modern World) is very thin, theologically speaking. Whitehead was initially a reluctant theist. God appears as a metaphysical necessity—the evaluator and purveyor of universals—and little more.

It is important to note that although God’s envisagement of the eternal objects is “eternal” (that is, causally outside of the temporal flow), God’s own being is that of an everlasting actual entity (Whitehead) or an everlasting society of discrete actual occasions (Hartshorne). Process philosophy’s dedication to naturalism prohibits the postulation of any entities that are exempt from metaphysical principles, especially God, who should be the chief exemplification of the world’s metaphysical principles rather than their sole exception. The tension in the process conception of God between an eternal and unchanging evaluation of eternal objects and a temporal entity internally related to every other actuality has led to Whitehead’s “dipolar” doctrine of God. It is useful to think about God’s being by means of two abstractions: God’s primordial nature and God’s consequent nature. The primordial nature envisages and orders the eternal objects into a single unimaginably complex ideal. The consequent nature of God interacts with the world, prehending fully every single actual occasion in the world upon its concrescence and, thus, preserving the past. This consequent nature of God is the aspect of God that is continuously changing as the world changes and feels every experience in the world with subjective immediacy.

Process philosophers also characterize God’s relation to the world as one of mutual transcendence, mutual immanence, and mutual creation. For example, God transcends the world insofar as God is able to fully synthesize and integrate every occasion in the world and compare that world with the primordial envisagement of ideals. The world transcends God insofar as it is not subject to divine fiat and can disregard God’s lures or presentation of novel possibilities. Likewise, God is the creator of the world in the sense that an orchestra conductor or a poet is a creator—organizing and directing elements that frequently surprise or misinterpret. The world creates God in the sense that the data from the world are internally related and constitutive of God’s being.

The doctrine of God established by process philosophy is a significant departure from previous models of the God-World relation. Process philosophy does not endorse classical theism, understood as the doctrine that God is completely transcendent, supernatural, beyond time and space, simple, and unchanging. Nor does process philosophy endorse pure immanence or pantheism, the doctrine that the world and God are identical and that God is nothing more than the sum of entities in the world. Instead, process philosophy endorses panentheism, the belief that all is in God and God is immanent everywhere in the universe, but is more than the universe. A frequently used analogy here is that the universe is God’s body and God is the consciousness that directs and interacts with that body. God is the divine subject of all experience.

b. Freedom and the Problem of Evil

Because every actual entity, including God, is an instance of creativity and is therefore experiential and self-determining, God is incapable of overriding the self-determination of the creaturely occasions. To exist at all is to be composed of creativity and this necessarily implies both an element of self-determination and a particular pattern of causal relation with all other entities. God is not to be treated as an exception to all metaphysical principles, invoked to save their collapse. God is their chief exemplification. (Process and Reality, 343). God prehends and is prehended just as billions of other actualities are prehended. Ultimately, the syntheses of these data (including divine data) are determined by the concrescing entity, whether that entity is an atmospheric molecule or a human being. God’s power over the world is described as persuasive rather than coercive. God cannot override the self-directed integrations of feeling present in the concrescence of any occasion—God cannot force human beings to make any particular decision and cannot supernaturally intervene in natural processes. God’s power is that of presenting novel eternal objects (possibilities) as a “lure” to the creaturely occasions. For this reason, the God of process philosophy is not omnipotent, if one’s definition of omnipotence includes the ability to perform any conceivable action.

This denial of omnipotence (see Charles Hartshorne’s Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes) is process philosophy’s solution to the problem of evil. Because the power of self-determination is a quality of Becoming itself, anything that exists must necessarily possess self-determination. God’s benevolence is not at odds with the existence of moral and natural evils in the world because God’s power cannot prevent creaturely occasions from ignoring the divine lures and acting in a less-than-ideal fashion.

6. Non-theistic Variations

Some later process philosophers (for example, Donald Sherburne, Robert C. Mesle) dispute whether God is truly necessary to Whitehead’s system. They argue that a non-theistic or “naturalistic” version of process philosophy is more useful and coherent. This movement, classically expressed by Donald Sherburne’s 1971 article “Whitehead without God,” observes that Whitehead believes that God is metaphysically necessary because God (a) preserves the past; (b) is the ontological ground, or “somewhere” of the eternal objects; and (c) is the source of order, novelty, and limitation in worldly occasions. Sherburne argues that these roles for God are inconsistent with the metaphysical principles of Whitehead’s system and are superfluous. According to Whitehead’s own principles, God cannot be the ground for the givenness of the past. Likewise, the eternal objects need not be located in an everlasting divine actuality—a rather Platonic formulation—but could be inchoate in the flux of worldly actualities themselves—a more Aristotelian view. Finally, Sherburne points out that a principle of limitation can arise from the naturally ordered causal relevance of the past rather than God. A concrescing occasion is most heavily influenced by the preceding occasion in its immediate past and the determinate character of this occasion limits the possibilities of the present.

7. Process Philosophy as Constructive Postmodernism

“Modernity” in itself is a rather diffuse term, which means many things to many people, and especially varies depending on the disciplinary context. The term “postmodern” is even more ambiguous (and abused). Process philosophy’s place in the history of philosophy is somewhat of an enigma, due to its ambivalent relationship with modernity. In some ways, process philosophy seems pre-modern by virtue of its neo-classicism and unapologetic metaphysical speculation. Process philosophy also embraces modernity in its dedication to the importance of natural science and its metaphysical realism. It is also post-modern in its rejection of both substance metaphysics and the notion of an enduring self.

Many process philosophers, following the lead of David Ray Griffin, refer to their own work as “constructive postmodernism” in order to differentiate it from the deconstruction program of Jacques Derrida, Jean-François Lyotard, Michel Foucault, and others. The latter movements seek to dismantle the notions of system, self, God, purpose, meaning, reality, and truth in order to prevent, among other things, oppressive totalities and hegemonic narratives that arose in the Modern period. Constructive postmodernism, on the other hand, seeks emancipation from the negative aspects of modernity through revision rather than elimination. Constructive postmodernism seeks to revise and re-synthesize the insights and positive features of Modernity into a post-anthropocentric, post-individualistic, post-materialist, post-nationalist, post-patriarchal, and post-consumerist worldview. For example, modernity’s worship of scientific achievement, combined with lingering Aristotelian doctrines of substance and efficient causation may have led to a mechanistic materialist worldview. Deconstructive postmodernism would combat this worldview by undermining the efficacy of science, claiming that all observational statements are actually about our own culturally-constituted conceptual scheme, not about an independently real world. Constructive postmodernism seeks instead to leave natural science intact, because empirical observation itself produces evidence against mechanism and materialism when it takes in a sufficiently broad data set (that is, all of human experience, and not just experience of “physical” objects).

8. Conclusion

Many thinkers have found process philosophy to be most useful because of this ambivalent stance. Whitehead’s own method for resolving philosophical difficulties was to see the polar oppositions present in any philosophical debate (idealism vs. materialism; libertarianism vs. determinism) as two exaggerated positions that arise from an inappropriately narrow selection of data and evidence. Solutions to problems, for process philosophy, are always to be found in novel syntheses of the past judgments.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Bergson, Henri. Creative Evolution (Kessinger Publications, 2003).
  • Bergson, Henri. The Creative Mind: An Introduction to Metaphysics (Citadel Press, 1992).
  • Browning, Douglas and William T. Myers, eds. Philosophers of Process (New York: Fordham, 1998).
    • This anthology collects important essays from the broader tradition of process philosophy—C.S. Peirce, William James, Friedrich Nietzsche, Samuel Alexander, Henri Bergson, John Dewey, A.N. Whitehead, George Herbert Mead, and Charles Hartshorne.
  • Hartshorne, Charles. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method (Chicago: Open Court, 1970).
    • Hartshorne tackles classical issues in philosophy: proofs for theism, metaphysics and language, a priori knowledge, aesthetic value, and the nature of reality.
  • Hartshorne, Charles. Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers (Albany: SUNY Press, 1983).
    • Hartshorne presents his own systematic philosophical views by commenting on the major figures in the history of philosophy from the Pre-Socratics to Merleau-Ponty and Sartre.
  • Hartshorne, Charles. Creativity in American Philosophy (Albany: SUNY Press, 1984).
    • Hartshorne comments on the major figures in American philosophy, focusing on their metaphysical commitments, and treatment of “creativity.”
  • Hartshorne, Charles. Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes (Albany: SUNY Press, 1984).
    • This short, simple, and lucid work summarizes Hartshorne’s doctrine of God and related philosophical theology.
  • Hartshorne, Charles. The Zero Fallacy (Chicago: Open Court, 1997).
    • This anthology presents diverse essays by Hartshorne on classical theism, democracy, the logic of contrasts, the nature of metaphysics, the mind-body problem, and even ornithology.
  • Whitehead, Alfred North. Science and the Modern World (New York: The Free Press, 1925).
    • By arguing that the rise of modern science is a contingent and idiosyncratic cultural fluke, rather than an inevitable intellectual achievement, Whitehead establishes the framework for his own holistic metaphysical system.
  • Whitehead, Alfred North. Religion in the Making (New York: Fordham, 1926).
    • By examining the history, phenomenology, and sociology of religion, Whitehead discusses the important interrelation of religious experience, scientific experience, and metaphysical philosophy.
  • Whitehead, Alfred North. Process and Reality (New York: The Free Press, 1929).
    • In his highly technical and dense opus, Whitehead systematically describes his unique “philosophy of organism.”
  • Whitehead, Alfred North. Adventures of Ideas (New York: The Free Press, 1933).
    • By examining the history of civilization, Whitehead explores the notions of widescale moral progress of civilization, the infusion of values and ideals in the world, the God-world relation, and the importance of novelty and adventure for human inquiry.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Cobb, John B., Jr. and Griffin, David Ray. Process Theology: An Introductory Exposition (Philadelphia: Westminster Press, 1976).
    • This book applies the metaphysics of Whitehead and Hartshorne to explicitly theological problems.
  • Cobb, John B., Jr. and Griffin, David Ray. Postmodernism and Public Policy: Reframing Religion, Culture, Education, Sexuality, Class, Race, Politics, and the Economy (Albany: SUNY Press, 2001).
    • John B. Cobb, Jr. uses a Whiteheadian perspective to address matters of public policy and social justice.
  • Cloots, Andre, and Robinson, Keith A.. Deleuze, Whitehead, and the Transformation of Metaphysics (Brussels: Flämische Akademie der Wissenschaften, 2005).
    • This work places Whitehead in conversation with French poststructuralist Gilles Deleuze.
  • Dombrowski, Daniel. A Platonic Philosophy of Religion (Albany: SUNY Press, 2006).
    • This work’s interpretive framework derives from the application of process philosophy and discusses the continuation of Plato’s thought in the works of Hartshorne and Whitehead.
  • Griffin, David Ray. God, Power, and Evil: A Process Theodicy (Philadelphia, Westminster, 1976).
    • This work compares traditional theodicies with the Whiteheadian-Hartshornean solution to the problem of evil.
  • Griffin, David Ray. Reenchantment without Supernaturalism: A Process Philosophy of Religion (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2001).
    • This book uses process philosophy as an explanatory scheme for major issues in the philosophy of religion—religious language, religious experience and perception, freedom, evil, and morality.
  • Griffin, David Ray et al. Founders of Constructive Postmodern Philosophy: Peirce, James, Bergson, Whitehead, and Hartshorne. (Albany: SUNY Press, 1993).
    • This volume discusses process philosophy as a distinctively postmodern trajectory of thought.
  • Jones, Judith. Intensity: An Essay in Whiteheadian Ontology (Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 1998).
  • Keller, Catherine and Anne Daniell, eds. Process and Difference: Between Cosmological and Poststructuralist Postmodernisms (Albany: SUNY Press, 2002).
    • This collection of essays engages the process philosophical tradition with the poststructuralist movements.
  • LeClerc, Ivor. Whitehead’s Metaphysics (New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1958).

Author Information

J. R. Hustwit
Email: jhustwit@methodist.edu
Methodist University
U. S. A.

Panpsychism

Panpsychism is the view that all things have a mind or a mind-like quality. The word itself was coined by the Italian philosopher Francesco Patrizi in the sixteenth century, and derives from the two Greek words pan (all) and psyche (soul or mind). This definition is quite general, and raises two immediate questions: (1) What does one mean by “all things”? (2) What does one mean by “mind”? On the first question, some philosophers have argued that literally every object in the universe, every part of every object, and every system of objects possesses some mind-like quality. Other philosophers have been more restrictive, arguing that only certain broad classes of things possess mind (in which case one is perhaps not a true panpsychist), or that, at least, the smallest parts of things—such as atoms—possess mind. The second question—what is mind?—is more difficult and contentious. Here panpsychism is on neither better nor worse footing than any other approach to mind; it argues only that one’s notion of mind, however conceived, must apply in some degree to all things.

The panpsychist conception of mind must be sufficiently broad to plausibly encompass humans and non-human objects as well. Panpsychists typically see the human mind as a unique, highly-refined instance of some more universal concept. They argue that mind in, say, lower animals, plants, or rocks is neither as sophisticated nor as complex as that of human beings. But this in turn raises new questions: What common mental quality or qualities are shared by these things? And why should we even call such qualities “mental” in the first place?

Panpsychism, then, is not a formal theory of mind. Rather, it is a conjecture about how widespread the phenomenon of mind is in the universe. Panpsychism does not necessarily attempt to define “mind” (although many panpsychists do this), nor does it necessarily explain how mind relates to the objects that possess it. As a result, panpsychism is more of an overarching concept, a kind of meta-theory of mind. More details are required to incorporate it into a fully-developed theory of mind.

A view such as panpsychism seems perhaps unlikely at first glance. And in fact many contemporary philosophers have argued that panpsychism is simply too fantastic or improbable to be true. However, there is actually a very long and distinguished history of panpsychist thinking in Western philosophy, from its beginnings in ancient Greece through the present day. Some of the greatest names in philosophy have argued for some form of panpsychism, or expressed a strong sympathy toward the idea. Notably, as we progress into the 21st century, we find the beginnings of a philosophical renaissance for the subject. Once again panpsychism is finding a place in the larger philosophical discourse, and is being explored in a number of different ways.

Table of Contents

  1. The Concept of Panpsychism
  2. A Historical Overview
    1. Ancient Philosophy
    2. Renaissance Thinking
    3. Eighteenth and Nineteenth Centuries
    4. Twentieth Century to the Present
  3. Arguments: Pro and Con
  4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism
  5. References and Further Reading

1. The Concept of Panpsychism

In a general sense, panpsychism may be defined as the view that all things possess mind, or some mind-like quality. The specific meanings of “all things” and “mind” vary widely among particular thinkers, but there is a broad consensus on three points. First, the mind in all things is something internal to, or inherent in, things themselves (as opposed to being injected or sustained by some outside entity). Second, such mind has a sort of focus or unity to it, in that it is typically assumed to be of a singular nature. Third, “things” usually (but not always) include systems or collections of lower-order entities; thus, a forest may be considered as a thing, though it is composed of a variety of individual trees, plants, animals, and so forth.

Panpsychist theories generally attempt to encompass both the material realm and the mental realm in a single comprehensive framework, in a way that fundamentally connects the two. These realms are central to many aspects of philosophy, but panpsychism lies at a unique intersection of the two, wherein mind is seen as fundamental to the nature of existence and being. It is at once an ontology and a theory of mind.

This latter point requires elaboration. Panpsychism, in itself, is not a theory of mind per se, because it does not in general give an account of the precise nature of mind, nor of how it relates to material things. Rather, it is a meta-theory; it is a theory about theories, a framework which says: However mind is to be conceived, it applies, in some sense, to all things.

Thus panpsychism can apply, in principle, to virtually any conventional theory of mind. There could exist, for example, a panpsychist substance dualism in which some Supreme Being grants a soul/mind to all things. There could be a panpsychist functionalism that interprets the functional role of every object as mind, even if such a role is only “to gravitate,” “to resist pressure,” and so forth. One could argue for a panpsychist identism in which mind is identical to matter; or a panpsychist reductive materialism in which the mind of each thing is reducible to its physical states. The only theories not amenable to panpsychism are those that (a) explicitly argue that only a certain restricted class of beings can possess mind (such as living things or Homo sapiens), or (b) deny the existence of mind altogether (that is, eliminativism). The fact that such restricted conceptions of mind are on shaky theoretical ground suggests that one should not rule out the panpsychist extension of other theories. Rather, the opposite view is perhaps the more reasonable: that one should hold panpsychism as a natural and logical extension of any given theory of mind, until demonstrated otherwise.

A few further points should be made clear at the outset of any discussion of panpsychism. First, philosophers typically do not take panpsychism in the literal sense, meaning all things have a soul; this interpretation of psyche is primarily a remnant of the theological philosophy of the Renaissance. Psyche is today most often interpreted as synonymous with mind or, in a secular sense, spirit.

Second, panpsychism needs to be distinguished from some closely related concepts: animism, hylozoism, pantheism, panentheism, and panexperientialism:

  • Animism, as commonly understood, is the view that all things possess a fully-developed, intelligent, and complex conscious-like spirit. It is a concept arising more from mythology than philosophy, and few panpsychists actually attribute human-like (or god-like) consciousness to all objects.
  • Hylozoism is the theory that everything is alive. This concept originated in ancient philosophy when the notion of life was less well-understood, and hence easily conflated with ideas of spirit and mind. Thus when past writers argue that “everything is alive” we are justified in interpreting this in a panpsychist light. The term has been used sporadically even through the early twentieth century, but based on our current understanding of living organisms, it is less useful or appropriate today.
  • Pantheism identifies everything, collectively, with God, as a single unified being. For the pantheist, the universe itself is God. In general this says nothing about individual things, nor about the nature of mind, and hence has no direct bearing on panpsychism (though some panpsychists do equate God with the cosmos, and hence are pantheists as well—Spinoza being the prime example).
  • Panentheism is the view that God penetrates, or is in, everything. Again, this typically assumes a single unified God, whose omnipresence is taken as the spirit in all things. Such a view is actually close to the standard Christian position, where the Holy Spirit dwells everywhere. But because it offers a notion of spirit as a part of a unified God, and not as spirit of the thing itself, it is not a true form of panpsychism.
  • Finally, panexperientialism is a term that was invented by process philosopher David Ray Griffin in the 1970’s. It holds that everything experiences, or is capable of experiencing.

Of the above terms, only panexperientialism deserves to be considered as true panpsychism; the others are either archaic or largely irrelevant. And due to the prominence of process philosophy over the past few decades, panexperientialism is perhaps the most widely discussed form of panpsychism today.

The process view of panpsychism raises a third issue. When process philosophers argue that all things have a mind or that all things experience, they refer to all “true” or “genuine” individuals. A human being is a genuine individual, as are all animals. One-celled microbes are included, as well as cells in the animal body. Plant cells count as individuals, but, interestingly, whole plants do not—based on a particular reading of some rather cryptic statements by Whitehead. On the process view, rocks and tables are not individuals, but the atoms and molecules that compose them are. Since atoms are seen as possessing mind, all material things are thereby enminded: either as individuals in themselves, or as a collection of sentient atoms. It should be emphasized, however, that the process view is a minority position; most panpsychists throughout history have held to the stronger view that all things possess mind.

Finally, it is clearly debatable what one means by “mind.” Panpsychists have employed a variety of descriptive terms to articulate the mental quality that all things share: sentience, experience, feeling, inner life, subjectivity, qualia, will, perception. In the vast majority of cases such terms are used in a very broad sense, and are not defined in a specifically human sense. In fact, panpsychists deliberately avoid terms that are too closely identified with uniquely human mental characteristics, such as consciousness (or self-consciousness), cognition, thought, belief, and the like. The usual intention is that only mind in the broadest sense is applicable to all things.

2. A Historical Overview

a. Ancient Philosophy

Panpsychism is an ancient concept in Western philosophy, predating even the earliest writings of the pre-Socratics. It was in fact an essential part of the cosmology into which philosophy was born. Thus we should not be too surprised to find its influence recurring throughout our history.

We see evidence of this at the very beginning of philosophy, in the few remaining fragments of Thales, the man widely regarded as the first philosopher of ancient Greece. Thales believed that the lodestone (magnet) possessed a psyche or soul: “According to Thales…the lodestone has a soul because it moves iron” (Aristotle, De Anima, 405a19). Furthermore, the power of the lodestone was seen as a particularly powerful manifestation of a divine animate quality shared by all things: “Certain thinkers say that soul is intermingled in the whole universe, and it is perhaps for that reason that Thales came to the opinion that all things are full of gods” (Ibid, 411a7).

Other pre-Socratics held similar views:

  • Anaximenes put forth the pneuma (air) as the underlying arche, or ruling principle, of the cosmos. Pneuma has a number of related meanings, many of which correspond closely with psyche; in addition to “air” it can also mean breath, soul, spirit, or mind. Since pneuma penetrates and underlies all things, this implies that all things are endowed with a spiritual or soul-like quality.
  • Heraclitus’ arche was fire. Fire, like the pneuma, was associated with life-energy; thus Heraclitus referred to this fire not merely as pyr, but as pyr aeizoon – an “ever-living fire.” Consequently, this life-energy was seen as residing in all things: “All things are full of souls and of divine spirits” (Smith, 1934: 13). In another fragment he proclaimed: “The thinking faculty is common to all” (Freeman, 1948: 32).
  • Anaxagoras envisioned the world as composed of a myriad of substances, but these were ordered and regulated by the single over-arching principle of nous (mind). Nous was a unifying, cosmic mental force that was interwoven with the movement and actions of disparate elements. The mind that is ubiquitous is not just some amorphous, abstract mind, but essentially like that of animals, that is, an animated soul or spirit: “[J]ust as in animals, so in nature, mind is present and responsible for the world…” (Aristotle, Metaphysics, 984b15).

Of special note is the thinking of Empedocles. He invented the four-element view of the cosmos—fire, air, water, and earth—that held for nearly two millennia. All things, including psyche, were composed of these four substances. Furthermore, the elements themselves were seen as ensouled: “Empedocles [says that the soul] is composed of all the elements and that each of them actually is a soul” (Aristotle, De Anima, 404b11). These elements were presided over by two animate forces, Love (attraction) and Strife (repulsion). Hence panpsychism was central to Empedocles’ worldview. Guthrie (1962-81: 233) stated that “it was in fact fundamental to Empedocles’ whole system that there is no distinction between animate and inanimate, and everything has some degree of awareness and power of discrimination.” Perhaps the clearest indication comes in fragment 103: “all things have the power of thought” (Smith, 1934: 31).

Moving to the heart of Greek philosophy, Plato made a number of intriguing comments in support of panpsychism. Notably, passages suggesting such a view occur in four of his last works – Sophist,PhilebusTimaeus, and Laws. This implies that they represent his mature thinking on the matter, and thus have some strong degree of significance in his overall metaphysical system.

Sophist discusses Plato’s ideas about the Form of Being. Since being, on Plato’s view, has the power of self-generating motion (247e), he concludes that the Form of Being must itself have an inherent psychic aspect:

O heavens, can we ever be made to believe that motion [kinesi] and life [zoe] and soul [psyche] and mind [phronesi] are not present with perfect being? Can we imagine that, being is devoid of life and mind, and exists in awful unmeaningness an everlasting fixture? — That would be a dreadful thing to admit (249a).

All real things participate in the Form of Being, as this is how they acquire their actual existence. Thus, everything may be said to participate in life, mind, and soul.

In the Philebus Plato introduced the concept of the anima mundi—the world-soul (30a). He argued that the universe, like the human body, is composed of the four Empedoclean elements (fire, air, water, earth). Both the human and the cosmos are well-ordered and exhibit clear signs of logos, of rationality. The body, though nothing more than a well-ordered combination of the elements, possesses a soul; therefore a reasonable implication is that the universe too, and everything in it, are ensouled. If this were not the case, then there must be something fundamentally unique about the structure of mankind and the cosmos that they alone are ensouled. Plato gave no indication that this is true and, in fact, argued later to the contrary.

Timaeus contains an account of how the creator of the universe—the Demiurge—brought the cosmos into existence, and endowed it with a world-soul. One learns that not only is the cosmos as a whole ensouled, but so too are the stars, individually; they are “divine living things” (40b), for which “[the Demiurge] assigned each soul to a star” (41e). As well the Earth, described as a “god” (40c), “foremost” in the cosmos. Later (77b) Plato explains that even plants possess the third kind of soul (appetitive), and thus are animate.

Finally, in Laws Plato offers perhaps his final statement on the matter:

Now consider all the stars and the moon and the years and the months and all the seasons: what can we do except repeat the same story? A soul or souls…have been shown to be the cause of all these phenomena, and whether it is by their living presence in matter…or by some other means, we shall insist that these souls are gods. Can anybody admit all this and still put up with people who deny that ‘everything is full of gods’? (899b).

In a nod to the famous line by Thales, Plato seems to resolve this issue for us: everything is full of gods.

Regarding Aristotle, we know that he viewed the psyche or soul as the form (or structure) of living things. Accordingly, non-living things have no soul—hence, technically, Aristotle was no panpsychist. But the question remains whether non-living things have something soul-like in them.

First, we note that there is a kind of evolutionary imperative in Aristotle’s thinking. He envisioned all of nature as continually striving toward “the better” or “the good” (see Physics 192a18; On Generation and Corruption 336b28; Eudemian Ethics 1218a30). By “better” Aristotle has in mind certain specific qualities; he comments that being is better than non-being, life better than non-life, and soul better than matter. Thus, as Rist (1989: 123) points out, there is a meaningful sense in which “the whole of the cosmos is permeated by some kind of upward desire and aspiration”—upward in the sense of toward form, life, and soul.

This outlook is essential to Aristotle because he sought to explain the puzzling phenomenon of spontaneous generation. Plant and animal life seem to materialize out of inanimate matter—such as the maggots and flies that quickly appear in decaying animal waste. How is this possible? The upward striving of matter is part of the explanation, but not the whole story.

Aristotle argued that all natural (as opposed to manmade) objects possess an inherent “principle of motion” (Physics 192b9). This fact permits one to see such motion as “an immortal never-failing property of things that are, a sort of life as it were to all naturally constituted things” (Physics, 250b12). The “sort of life” in matter was no idle concept, but directly connected to the process of spontaneous generation. This life-energy initiates the generative process, thus bringing into being true life and soul.

The life-energy in all things had to be grounded in some kind of substance, in order to be manifest in the real world. So Aristotle adopted, perhaps via Anaximenes, the notion of the pneuma. The pneuma is not, strictly speaking, mind or soul; rather, it is something soul-like. As he says in Generation of Animals, it is the “faculty of all kinds of soul,” the “vital heat” (thermoteta psychiken), the “principle of soul” (736b29).

The soul-like pneuma is ubiquitous in the natural world, penetrating and informing all things. It not only brings soul to the embryo and to the spontaneously-generated creatures, but it accounts for the general desire of matter for form, and for the good. Aristotle is explicit and unambiguous that all things are inspirited by the pneuma. With rather stunning clarity he informs us:

Animals and plants come into being in earth and in liquid because there is water in earth, and pneuma in water, and in all pneuma is vital heat, so that in a sense all things are full of soul (Generation of Animals 762a18-20).

Echoing panpsychist thinking from Thales to Plato, Aristotle apparently came to the conclusion that something soul-like, of varying degrees, inhered in all objects of the natural world.

Post-Aristotelian (Hellenistic) Greek philosophy continued to incorporate panpsychist themes. The two dominant schools of that era were those of Epicurus and the Stoics.

Epicurean physical theory relied heavily on the atomism of Democritus, and followed his central thesis of material objects as composed of atoms moving through the void. The early atomists held to a strict determinism, but this was problematic for Epicurus, as his ethical system required the existence of free will. He therefore discarded the determinism by introducing a new factor that he called “swerve” (parenklisis; in Latin, declinare, a deflection or turning-aside). The swerve was due to a tiny amount of free will exhibited by all atoms.

The willful swerving of the atoms is the basis for our own free will. As Lucretius describes it, “[Out of the swerve] rises, I say, that will torn free from fate, through which we follow wherever pleasure leads, and likewise swerve aside at times and places” (pp. 255-60). Human free will cannot arise ex nihilo (“since nothing, we see, could be produced from nothing”; p. 287), and hence must be present in the atoms themselves: “Thus to the atoms we must allow…one more cause of movement [namely, that of free will]—the one whence comes this power we own” (pp. 284-6). The necessary conclusion, then, is that since all things are composed of willful atoms, all things can be said to be animate.

The early Stoic philosophers— Zeno, Cleanthes, and Chrysippus—adopted many of their predecessors’ fundamental assumptions about the nature of being and mind, most importantly the Aristotelian/Anaximean conception of the pneuma. Composed of fire and air, the Stoic pneuma was put forth as the creative life energy of the universe. This was most evident in human bodies, in which both warmth (fire) and breath (air) were seen as the essential defining characteristics of life and soul. Pneuma was the active principle made tangible, and as such it accounted for all form that was seen in worldly objects. Pneuma was the “creative fire” of the cosmos, a pyr technikon. It had the status of divinity, and was equated with both god and cosmic reason.

A. A. Long (1974) notes that in the Stoic system “mind and matter are two constituents or attributes of one thing, body, and this analysis applies to human beings as it does to everything else” (p. 171). All material objects are “bodies,” and they are in fact “compounds of ‘matter’ and ‘mind’ (God or logos). Mind is not something other than body but a necessary constituent of it, the ‘reason’ in matter” (p. 174).

b. Renaissance Thinking

The end of Hellenism and the Stoic philosophy coincided with the beginnings of the monotheistic religious worldview. Monotheism and the Christian worldview were fundamentally opposed to panpsychism, and thus it is perhaps not surprising that we find relatively little articulation of panpsychist ideas for several centuries.

The next major advance did not occur until the Italian Renaissance. Five of the most important philosophers of that era—Cardano, Telesio, Patrizi, Bruno, and Campanella—were panpsychists.

Cardano was the first notable philosopher in over a millennium to put forth an unambiguous panpsychist philosophy. His ontological system consisted of a nested hierarchy in which each individual thing was seen as (1) a part (of the larger whole, or One), (2) a unity in itself, and (3) a composition of sub-parts. The fundamental principle maintaining the unity of each part was anima (soul); the particularly human form of this principle he recognized as mind. As the unifying principle, soul was present in all unities large and small.

Like Empedocles, Telesio saw two fundamental and opposing forces in the universe: an expanding and motive principle that he called heat, and a contracting principle, cold. These forces acted on and shaped the so-called third principle, passive matter, which was associated with the Earth. Every object was a composition of passive matter and the heat/cold principles. Heat and cold also had the notable property of perception. Heat sought to stay warm, and cold to stay cool, and this tendency Telesio interpreted as a kind of sensation or knowledge. As he says, “It is quite evident that nature is propelled by self-interest” (1586/1967: 304). And since heat and cold inhered in all things, all things shared in this ability to sense. Thus his position is sometimes referred to as pansensism, a particular form of panpsychism.

Patrizi’s chief work, New Philosophy of the Universe (1591), laid out a complete cosmological system, and introduced into the Western vocabulary the term “panpsychism.” Following the model of Ficino, Patrizi created a nine-level hierarchical system of being, with soul (anima) in the center. As such it permeated all levels, existing simultaneously at the level of the world-soul, the human soul, and the soul of inanimate things. “Patrizi does not treat the individual souls as [mere] parts of the world soul, but believes, rather, that their relation to their bodies is analogous to that of the world soul to the universe as a whole” (Kristeller, 1964: 122). Soul is “both [unity and plurality], with the many contained in the one” (Brickman, 1941: 41).

Bruno was very frank about his panpsychist view, and even acknowledged its unconventionality. In his 1584 dialogue, Cause, Principle and Unity, one character exclaims, “Common sense tells us that not everything is alive. … [W]ho will agree with you?” Another replies, “But who could reasonably refute it?” (1998: 42). Bruno believed that the same principles must apply throughout the cosmos; the Earth held no privileged position in the universe (such as being at the center), and humans held no privilege with respect to possessing a soul. He took the world-soul and the human soul as given, and concluded that all things, all parts of the whole, must be animated: “[N]ot only the form of the universe, but also all the forms of natural things are souls.” He adds, “there is nothing that does not possess a soul and that has no vital principle” (p. 43). The skeptic retorts: “Then a dead body has a soul? So, my clogs, my slippers, my boots…are supposedly animated?” Bruno clarifies his position by explaining that such “dead” things are not to be considered animate in themselves, but rather as containing elements that either are themselves animate or have the innate power of animation:

I say, then, that the table is not animated as a table, nor are the clothes as clothes…but that, as natural things and composites, they have within them matter and form [that is, soul]. All things, no matter how small and miniscule, have in them part of that spiritual substance… [F]or in all things there is spirit, and there is not the least corpuscle that does not contain within itself some portion that may animate it (p. 44).

Campanella’s system centered on his doctrine of the “three primalities”: power, wisdom, and love. These are three qualities that Campanella saw as residing in all things, from the lowliest rock to the human being, to God himself. He argued that all things possess wisdom and sensation, and therefore can be said to possess the power of knowing. First and foremost, things know themselves: “All things have the sensation of their own being and of their conservation. They exist, are conserved, operate, and act because they know” (in Bonansea, 1969: 156). Cassirer (1963: 148) noted “Panpsychism emerges as a simple corollary to his theory of knowledge.” We see this, very explicitly, in the subtitle of Campanella’s workDe sensu rerum:

A remarkable tract of occult philosophy in which the world is shown to be a living and truly conscious image of God, and all its parts and particles thereof to be endowed with sense perception, some more clearly, some more obscurely, to the extent required for the preservation of themselves and of the whole in which they share sensation.

Campanella offered a number of arguments in support of his panpsychism. For example, following Epicurus and Telesio he argued that “like comes from like,” that is, that emergence is impossible:

Now, if the animals are sentient…and sense does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have. Therefore the heavens are sentient, and so [too] the earth… (cited in Dooley, 1995: 39).

Campanella was an important thinker, but the two great panpsychists of the seventeenth century were certainly Spinoza and Leibniz. Spinoza created a radical monism in which the single underlying substance of all reality was what he identified as “God, or Nature.” God/Nature possessed two knowable attributes: mind (thought) and matter (extension).

In Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, every object has both its own unique mode of extension and its corresponding mode of thought (also called the “idea” of the object): “In God [/Nature] there is necessarily the idea…of all things…” (Ethics, II Prop 3). Moreover, the idea of an object has a very specific interpretation: it is the mind of that object. Since every object has a corresponding idea, every object can be said to have a mind. This is most apparent to us in our own case, wherein the human mind is simply the idea of the human body. But it is a general ontological principle, and thus applies to all things:

From these [propositions] we understand not only that the human mind is united to the body, but also what should be understood by the union of mind and body. […] For the things we have shown so far are completely general and do not pertain more to man than to other individuals, all of which, though in different degrees, are nevertheless animate. … [W]hatever we have asserted of the idea [that is, mind] of the human body must necessarily also be asserted of the idea of everything else (ibid: II Prop. 13, Scholium).

There is some considerable disagreement as to the proper interpretation of Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, and the meaning of the crucial Proposition 13 (above). Yet there seems to be a consensus in recent years that any proper reading will entail some form of panpsychism.

Leibniz’s panpsychism was based on his Monadology, or science of monads. Monads are the point-like constituents of reality, and they possess a number of characteristics that are related to mental qualities. The structure of the monad is to be understood as consisting of two primary qualities, “perception” and “appetite.” Perceptions are the changing internal states of the monads, and these changes are brought about (in a rather vague way) by the monad’s appetite; the appetite was a kind of seeking or desiring, a compelling need to reflect the universe.

The strongly animistic tone of the terms perception and appetite is not coincidental; each monad is identified with a soul:

I found that [the monad’s] nature consists in force, and that from this there follows something analogous to sensation [that is, perception] and appetite, so that we must conceive of them on the model of the notion we have of souls (1989: 139).

Monads themselves are unities, but so too, in a different way, are collections of monads. Any material object is such a collection, and is integrated by the action of a “dominant monad” which represents the integrated unity of the object. Leibniz, following Bruno, made a critical distinction between objects with a truly organic sense of unity and objects that are mere sets, collections, or aggregations of distinct things. Aggregates such as “an army or a flock,” or “a heap of stones” do not possess a dominant monad and thus no unified mind. Interestingly, Leibniz never gave a formal definition as to what qualifies as a group and what defines a true individual. Nonetheless, all things—even mere aggregates—possess mind, if only in their parts. Of this Leibniz was clear: “[W]e see that there is a world of creatures, of living beings, of animals, of entelechies, of souls in the least part of matter” (Monadology, sec. 66).

c. Eighteenth and Nineteenth Centuries

French thinkers Julien LaMettrie and Denis Diderot discarded the concept of the supernatural soul, and concluded that mind, or a mind-like nature, must be present in all matter. This was the view that came to be known as vitalistic materialism. Diderot’s work D’Alembert’s Dream (1769) put forth a very explicit panpsychist view: “this faculty of sensation…is a general and essential quality of matter” (1769/1937: 49). Throughout the dialogue one finds repeated references to the “general sensitivity of matter.” At one point he observes that “[f]rom the elephant to the flea, from the flea to the sensitive living atom, the origin of all, there is no point in nature but suffers and enjoys” (ibid: 80).

In the century following the French Enlightenment, panpsychist thought developed most rapidly in Germany. Among its more prominent advocates: Herder, Schopenhauer, Goethe, Fechner, Lotze, Hartmann, Mach, and Haeckel.

Herder was a dynamist philosopher who argued that Kraft (force or energy) was the single underlying substance of reality. As such it reflected both mental and physical properties. Herder sought to unify the diversity of forces (gravity, electricity, magnetism, and light) under the single framework of Kraft, of which the various Kraefte were different manifestations. The Kraft was at once material-energy, life-energy, spirit, and mind. “[Herder] represents the Kraefte of plants and stones as analogous to the soul. […] [E]ach endowed with a different degree of consciousness…” (Nisbet, 1970: 11). In 1784 he wrote: “All active forces of Nature are, each in its own way, alive; in their interior there must be Something that corresponds to their effects without—as Leibniz himself assumed….”

Schopenhauer’s masterwork, The World as Will and Idea (1819), describes a two-fold system of reality. From one perspective, the world is to be taken according to classical idealism—it exists only as our minds grasp and perceive it, hence as pure idea. On the other hand, the things of the world must also possess an inner reality. When we humans look inside ourselves, we find, ultimately, only forms of wanting, desiring, urging—in short, will. Yet we are material objects, not essentially unlike other material objects; hence all things, not just humans, are, on the inside, will:

We shall accordingly make further use of [the knowledge of the world as will and idea] as a key to the nature of every phenomenon in nature, and shall judge of all objects which are not our own bodies…according to the analogy of our own bodies, and shall therefore assume that as in one aspect they are idea, …so in another aspect, what remains of objects when we set aside their existence as idea of the subject, must in its inner nature be the same as that in us which we call will (1819/1995: 37).

Not just objects, but all the forces of nature are to be seen as forms of will: “[G]enerally every original force manifesting itself in physical and chemical appearances, in fact gravity itself—all these in themselves…are absolutely identical with what we find in ourselves as will” (1836/1993: 20).

Schopenhauer’s theory thus brings an effective unity to the notions of mind and matter:

Now if you suppose the existence of a mind in the human head, […] you are bound to concede a mind to every stone. […] [A]ll ostensible mind can be attributed to matter, but all matter can likewise be attributed to mind; from which it follows that the antithesis [between mind and matter] is a false one (1851/1974: 212-213).

Goethe developed a poetic form of panpsychism that displayed itself chiefly in his writings that personified nature. His most explicit statement came from a short essay of 1828: “Since, however, matter can never exist and act without spirit [Seele], nor spirit without matter, matter is also capable of undergoing intensification, and spirit cannot be denied its attraction and repulsion” (1988: 6). Here we find a beautifully concise articulation of panpsychism: no matter without mind, no mind without matter. This is not to say that mind is identical with matter, nor that one can be reduced to the other. It simply claims (like Spinoza and Schopenhauer) that neither mind nor matter exist without the other.

Fechner’s panpsychism was focused primarily on plant life. The fact that plants have a Seele is of critical importance to him because it serves as the basis for a completely panpsychic universe, and a corresponding new worldview. Fechner’s concept of the plant-soul was based, like Aristotle’s, on a comparison and analogy with other living beings:

[I]s not the plant quite as well organized as the animal, though on a different plan, a plan entirely of its own, perfectly consonant with its idea? If one will not venture to deny that the plant has a life, why deny it a soul? For it is much simpler to think that a different plan of bodily organization built upon the common basis of life indicates only a different plan of psychic organization (1848/1946: 168-9).

The Earth itself is “animated,” and is furthermore “an angel, so rich and fresh and blooming, … turning wholly towards heaven its animated face” (1861/1946: 150, 153). The animate Earth further implies “belief in the animate character of all other stars.”

Lotze’s central work, Microcosmos (1856-64/1885), described a comprehensive philosophical viewpoint based on a rejection of mechanistic thinking. He advocated the notion that all material objects have “a double life, appearing outwardly as matter, and as such manifesting…mechanical [properties, while] internally, on the other hand, moved mentally…” (p. 150). He concluded that “no part of being is any longer devoid of life and animation” (p. 360). Lotze acknowledged the prima facie improbability of his panpsychist view: “Who could endure the thought that in the dust trodden by our feet, in the…cloth that forms our clothing, in the materials shaped into all sorts of utensils…, there is everywhere present the fullness of animated life…?” (p. 361). Ultimately it is the “beauty of the living form [that] is made to us more intelligible by this hypothesis” (p. 366).

Eduard von Hartmann further developed Schopenhauer’s system of the world as will and idea, combining elements of Leibniz, Schelling, and Hegel into a doctrine of spiritual monism. He articulated a worldview in which the unconscious will is the cause of all things. The fact that matter is resolvable into will and idea led Hartmann to accept “the essential likeness of Mind and Matter” (1869/1950, vol. 2: 81): “The identity of mind and matter [becomes] elevated to a scientific cognition, and that, too, not by killing the spirit but by vivifying matter” (ibid: 180).

Mach’s philosophical writings emerged in the early 1880’s. A strong empiricist, he developed a neutral monistic philosophy in which the primary substance of existence was something that he called “sensations.” This realization led him rather suddenly to a panpsychist conception of reality: “Properly speaking the world is not composed of ‘things’…but of colors, tones, pressures, spaces, times, in short what we ordinarily call individual sensations” (1883/1974: 579). Recalling Schopenhauer’s tone, Mach wrote:

We shall then discover that our hunger is not so essentially different from the tendency of sulphuric acid for zinc, and our will not so greatly different from the pressure of a stone, as now appears. We shall again feel ourselves nearer nature, without its being necessary that we should resolve ourselves into a nebulous and mystical mass of molecules, or make nature a haunt of hobgoblins (ibid: 560).

Haeckel developed a monistic philosophy in which both evolution and the unity of all natural phenomena played a major part. The unity and relation of all living things convinced him that all dualities were false, especially the Cartesian dualism of body and mind. Haeckel was explicitly panpsychist by 1892: “One highly important principle of my monism seems to me to be, that I regard all matter as ensouled, that is to say as endowed with feeling (pleasure and pain) and motion…” (p. 486). He offered one argument for panpsychism, namely that “all natural bodies possess determinate chemical properties,” the most important being that of “chemical affinity.” This affinity, Haeckel argued, can only be explained “on the supposition that the molecules… mutually feel each other” (p. 483). Three years later he observed, “Our conception of Monism…is clear and unambiguous; …an immaterial living spirit is just as unthinkable as a dead, spiritless material; the two are inseparably combined in every atom” (1895: 58).

By the latter part of the nineteenth century, panpsychist thought began to develop in England and America. The first major British panpsychist of that time was William Kingdon Clifford. He believed in a form of Spinozist parallelism—that some process of mind exists concurrently with all forms of matter. Clifford cited evolutionary continuity in arguing that there is no point in the chain of material organization at which mind can be conceived to suddenly appear. Fellow Briton Herbert Spencer wrote an article in 1884 explaining that modern physics has revealed the “incredible power” of matter. The scientist is forced to conclude that:

every point in space thrills with an infinity of vibrations passing through it in all directions; the conception to which [the enlightened scientist] tends is much less that of a Universe of dead matter than that of a Universe everywhere alive: alive if not in the restricted sense, still in a general sense (1884: 10).

Royce’s 1892 book, Spirit of Modern Philosophy, introduced a form of panpsychism based on absolute idealism: “The theory of the ‘double aspect’, applied to the facts of the inorganic world, suggests at once that they, too, in so far as they are real, must possess their own inner and appreciable aspect” (1892: 419-20). A few years later he added this observation:

[W]e have no sort of right to speak in any way as if the inner experience behind any fact of nature were of a grade lower than ours, or less conscious, or less rational, or more atomic. […] [T]his reality is, like that of our own experience, conscious, organic, full of clear contrasts, rational, definite. We ought not to speak of dead nature (1898/1915: 230).

Charles Peirce’s article, “Man’s Glassy Essence” (1892), begins by noting “[T]here is fair analogical inference that all protoplasm feels. It not only feels but exercises all the functions of mind” (1892/1992: 343). And yet protoplasm is simply complex chemistry, a particular arrangement of molecules. We are therefore compelled “[to] admit that physical events are but degraded or undeveloped forms of psychical events” (ibid: 348). Peirce then laid out his own dual-aspect theory of mind:

[A]ll mind is directly or indirectly connected with all matter, and acts in a more or less regular way; so that all mind more or less partakes of the nature of matter. […] Viewing a thing from the outside, […] it appears as matter. Viewing it from the inside, […] it appears as consciousness (ibid: 349).

d. Twentieth Century to the Present

William James first addressed the subject of panpsychism in his Principles of Psychology. He devoted a full chapter to Clifford’s mind-stuff theory, and displayed notable sympathy to the view. James’ first personal endorsement of panpsychism came in his Harvard lecture notes of 1902-3, in which he noted, “pragmatism would be [my] method and ‘pluralistic panpsychism’ [my] doctrine” (Perry, 1935: 373). In his 1905-6 lecture notes he observed: “Our only intelligible notion of an object in itself is that it should be an object for itself, and this lands us in panpsychism and a belief that our physical perceptions are effects on us of ‘psychical’ realities…” (ibid: 446).

James arrived at a clear and unambiguous position in his 1909 book, A Pluralistic Universe. He explained that his theory of radical empiricism is a form of pluralist monism in which all things are both pure experience and “for themselves,” that is, are objects with their own independent psychical perspectives. In the end he endorsed “a general view of the world almost identical with Fechner’s” (ibid: 309-10). He saw in this new worldview “a great empirical movement towards a pluralistic panpsychic view of the universe” (ibid: 313).

In the early part of the twentieth century, panpsychist philosophy continued to develop rapidly in England and the USA. The dominant philosophical system, the one most connected with panpsychism, was Process Philosophy. Its earliest advocates were Bergson and Whitehead.

Bergson wrote Creative Evolution in 1907. His thesis—that matter is “the lowest degree of mind”—echoes Peirce. He added, following Schopenhauer, that “pure willing [is the] current that runs through matter, communicating life to it” (1907/1911: 206). But Bergson’s clearest elaboration came in Duration and Simultaneity (1922). Here he achieved a true process philosophy wherein all physical events contain a memory of the past. Given his earlier insistence that memory is essential to mind, one can see the conclusion that mind, or consciousness, is in all things:

What we wish to establish is that we cannot speak of a reality that endures without inserting consciousness into it. … [I]t is impossible to imagine or conceive a connecting link between the before and after without an element of memory and, consequently, of consciousness. … We may perhaps feel averse to the use of the word “consciousness” if an anthropomorphic sense is attached to it. [But] there is no need to take one’s own memory and transport it, even attenuated, into the interior of the thing. … It is the opposite course we must follow. … [D]uration is essentially a continuation of what no longer exists into what does exist. This is real time, perceived and lived. … Duration therefore implies consciousness; and we place consciousness at the heart of things for the very reason that we credit them with a time that endures (1922/1965: 48-49).

Whitehead’s panpsychism is relatively well known. It is based in his view of an “occasion of experience” as the ultimate particle of reality, and as possessing both a physical pole and a mental pole. If things are nothing but occasions, and occasions are in part mental, then all things have a mental dimension. In Modes of Thought (1938), in the chapter titled “Nature Alive,” he observed, “this [traditional] sharp division between mentality and nature has no ground in our fundamental observation. […] I conclude that we should conceive mental operations as among the factors which make up the constitution of nature” (p. 156).

Bertrand Russell ultimately came to a neutral monist view in which events were the primary reality, and mind and matter were both constructed from them. After some early, suggestive comments, he became increasingly supportive of panpsychism in the late 1920’s. Russell’s book An Outline of Philosophy(1927) directly addressed this. He wrote: “My own feeling is that there is not a sharp line, but a difference of degree [between mind and matter]; an oyster is less mental than a man, but not wholly un-mental” (p. 209). Part of the reason why we cannot draw a line, he says, is that an essential aspect of mind is memory, and a memory of sorts is displayed even by inanimate objects: “we cannot, on this ground [of memory], erect an absolute barrier between mind and matter. … [I]nanimate matter, to some slight extent, shows analogous behavior” (p. 306). In the summary he adds,

The events that happen in our minds are part of the course of nature, and we do not know that the events which happen elsewhere are of a totally different kind. The physical world…is perhaps less rigidly determined by causal laws than it was thought to be; one might, more or less fancifully, attribute even to the atom a kind of limited free will (p. 311).

Perhaps Russell’s clearest statement came in his Portraits from Memory (1956). Memory is “the most essential characteristic of mind, … using this word [memory] in its broadest sense to include every influence of past experience on present reactions” (pp. 153-4). As before, memory applies to all physical objects and systems:

This [memory] also can be illustrated in a lesser degree by the behavior of inorganic matter. A watercourse which at most times is dry gradually wears a channel down a gully at the times when it flows, and subsequent rains follow [a similar] course… You may say, if you like, that the river bed ‘remembers’ previous occasions when it experienced cooling streams. … You would say [this] was a flight of fancy because you are of the opinion that rivers and river beds do not ‘think’. But if thinking consists of certain modifications of behavior owing to former occurrences, then we shall have to say that the river bed thinks, though its thinking is somewhat rudimentary (p. 155).

In contrast to Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne articulated a clear and explicit form of process panpsychism. Beginning with his Beyond Humanism (1937), he laid out the unambiguous position that all true individuals possess a kind of psyche: “Molecules, atoms, and electrons all show more analogy of behavior to animals than do sticks and stones. The constitutions of inorganic masses may then after all belong on the scale of organic being…” (pp. 111-112). Elaborating on this notion over four decades, through such articles as “Panpsychism” (1950), “Physics and Psychics” (1977), and “The Rights of the Subhuman World” (1979), his panpsychism (or, “psychicalism”) is a clear and consistent theme. He combined the insights of Leibniz with Whitehead’s process view into a system which, he claimed, resolved many long-standing philosophical problems: most notably that it serves as a third way between dualism and materialism. Ultimately, panpsychism/psychicalism is, he says, the most viable ontology available to us—certainly preferable to an utterly unintelligible materialism: “the concept of ‘mere dead insentient matter’ is an appeal to invincible ignorance. At no time will this expression ever constitute knowledge” (1977: 95).

Many other great thinkers of the twentieth century promoted panpsychist ideas, including:

  • F. S. C. Schiller: “A stone, no doubt, does not apprehend us as spiritual beings… But does this amount to saying that it does not apprehend us at all, and takes no note whatever of our existence? Not at all; it is aware of us and affected by us on the plane on which its own existence is passed… It faithfully exercises all the physical functions, and influences us by so doing. It gravitates and resists pressure, and obstructs…vibrations, and so forth, and makes itself respected as such a body. And it treats us as if of a like nature with itself, on the level of its understanding…” (1907: 442).
  • Samuel Alexander: “there is nothing dead, or senseless in the universe, [even] Space-Time itself being animated”(1920: 69).
  • John Dewey : “[T]here is nothing which marks off the plant from the physico-chemical activity of inanimate bodies. The latter also are subject to conditions of disturbed inner equilibrium, which lead to activity in relation to surrounding things, and which terminate after a cycle of changes…” (1925: 253).
  • Sir Arthur Eddington: “The stuff of the world is mind-stuff” (1928: 276).
  • J. B. S. Haldane: “We do not find obvious evidence of life or mind in so-called inert matter…; but if the scientific point of view is correct, we shall ultimately find them, at least in rudimentary form, all through the universe” (1932: 13).
  • J. Huxley: “[M]ind or something of the nature as mind must exist throughout the entire universe. This is, I believe, the truth” (1942: 141).
  • Teilhard de Chardin: “there is necessarily a double aspect to [matter’s] structure… [C]o-extensive with their Without, there is a Within to things.” “[W]e are logically forced to assume the existence in rudimentary form…of some sort of psyche in every corpuscle, even in those (the mega-molecules and below) whose complexity is of such a low or modest order as to render it (the psyche) imperceptible…” (1959: 56, 301).
  • C. H. Waddington: “[S]omething must go on in the simplest inanimate things which can be described in the same language as would be used to describe our self-awareness” (1961: 121).
  • Gregory Bateson: “The elementary cybernetic system with its messages in circuit is, in fact, the simplest unit of mind; … More complicated systems are perhaps more worthy to be called mental systems, but essentially this is what we are talking about. … We get a picture, then, of mind as synonymous with cybernetic system… [W]e know that within Mind in the widest sense there will be a hierarchy of subsystems, any one of which we can call an individual mind” (1972: 459-60).
  • Freeman Dyson: “The laws [of physics] leave a place for mind in the description of every molecule… In other words, mind is already inherent in every electron, and the processes of human consciousness differ only in degree and not in kind…” (1979: 249).
  • David Bohm: “That which we experience as mind…will in a natural way ultimately reach the level of the wavefunction and of the ‘dance’ of the particles. There is no unbridgeable gap or barrier between any of these levels. … It is implied that, in some sense, a rudimentary consciousness is present even at the level of particle physics” (1986: 131).

Panpsychism enters the 21st century with vigor and diversity of thought. A number of recent works have focused attention on it. If we look back to the year 1996 we find two books that contributed to a resurrection of sorts. First, Chalmers’ The Conscious Mind lays out a naturalistic dualism theory of mind in which he suggests (with an apparent diffidence) that mind can be associated with ubiquitous information states—following Bateson and Bohm, though without citing their panpsychist views. His relatively detailed discussion of panpsychism sparked a resurgence of discussion on the matter, and contributed to a wider interest. Also, Abram’s Spell of the Sensuous argued from a phenomenological basis for a return to an animistic worldview, though his work was more poetic essay than detailed philosophical inquiry. In 1998 process philosopher David Ray Griffin published Unsnarling the World-Knot, a major milestone in panpsychist philosophy. Griffin supplies a detailed and scholarly assessment of the subject, though with a strong focus on the process view, and with only a cursory historical study.

Into the present century, Christian DeQuincey’s Radical Nature (2002) offers another process perspective, and a more satisfying review of the historical aspect. In 2003 there were two more books dedicated to panpsychism: David Clarke’s Panpsychism and the Religious Attitude, and Freya Mathews’ For Love of Matter. Clarke again takes the process view, underscoring the dominance of this philosophical perspective on the discussion. Mathews moves into new territory; drawing inspiration from Schopenhauer, she crafts a truly metaphysical philosophy in which humans are sensitive participants in an animate cosmos. Gregg Rosenberg released a nominally panpsychist approach to mind in 2004, with his book A Place for Consciousness. In 2005, Skrbina published the first-ever comprehensive study of the subject, Panpsychism in the West. Most recently, Galen Strawson has presented a forceful argument for panpsychism based on the inexplicability of emergence of mind (see Section 4).

Thus, at present we can discern at least six active lines of inquiry into panpsychism:

  1. the Process Philosophy view, as conceived by Bergson and Whitehead, and developed by Hartshorne, Griffin, DeQuincey, and Clarke;
  2. the Quantum Physics approach, as developed by Bohm, Hameroff, and others;
  3. the Information Theory approach, arising from the work of Bateson, Wheeler (1994), Bohm, and Chalmers;
  4. the Part-Whole Hierarchy, as envisioned by Cardano and elaborated by Koestler (1967) and Wilber (1995);
  5. the Nonlinear Dynamics approach, as inspired by Peirce (1892) and further articulated by Skrbina (1994, 2001); and
  6. Strawson’s (2006) “real physicalism” (see Section 4).

These areas all offer significant opportunity for development and articulation. They hold out the hope of resolving otherwise intractable problems of emergentism and mechanism, especially when so many conventional approaches have reached a dead end. As Nagel, Searle, and others have noted, the problems of mind and consciousness are so difficult that “drastic actions” are warranted—perhaps even as drastic as panpsychism.

Panpsychism, with its long list of advocates and sympathizers, is a robust and respectable approach to mind. It offers a naturalistic escape from Cartesian dualism and Christian theology. And, by undermining the mechanistic worldview, it promises to resolve not only long-standing philosophical problems but persistent social and ecological problems as well. Many great thinkers, from Empedocles and Epicurus to Campanella and LaMettrie, Fechner and James to Gregory Bateson, have recognized the potential for the panpsychist view to fundamentally alter, for the better, our outlook on the world. An animated worldview is not only philosophically rigorous, but it can have far-reaching and unanticipated effects.

3. Arguments: Pro and Con

An analysis of historical views, and recent discussions by such individuals as Griffin (1998), Popper (1977), McGinn (1997), and Seager (1995), demonstrate a number of distinct arguments for, and against, panpsychism. Skrbina (2005) identifies a total of six objections and twelve supporting arguments, though with some overlap between them. Below is a summary of the more compelling arguments and objections.

The first major argument for panpsychism is also one of the oldest: the Argument from Continuity. This argument, which is expressed in a variety of forms, claims that there is some critical thread of continuity among all things—a thread intimately related to the processes of mind. The particular entity that is continuous varies, but is typically expressed as either a substance or as a common form, structure, or function. We humans possess mind-like qualities that are a direct consequence of some substance, form, or structure; hence all things, to the degree that they share this common nature, have a corresponding share in mentality.

This is best illustrated through examples. The earliest such argument was presented by Anaximenes, with his arche of pneuma. As a kind of airy spirit, the pneuma accounted for our own minds but also permeated and sustained the entire cosmos and all things in it. Anaxagoras’ nous, and Heraclitus’ pyr, or fire, served a similar purpose, and thus were also arguments by continuity. Empedocles and Plato argued for pluralist, rather than monist, continuity. They saw all things as composed of the four elements (fire, air, water, and earth), and these elements were either souls in themselves (Empedocles), or the basis for human, cosmic, and other soul (Plato).

Among the German philosophers, Herder’s Kraft (force or power) played a similar role. For Schopenhauer, the will was our essential inner nature; since we are simply an “object among objects,” all things must possess an inner will. Fechner (1848/1946) emphasized the functional similarity between humans and, for example, plants. Though obviously different in many ways, living plants share essential functional qualities with humans, both representing a kind of living dynamism that suggests an inner striving and desire, a joy in being alive. Later, the American philosopher Dewey made a related case, stressing the continuity between living and nonliving systems.

At the heart of these arguments is an attempt to draw a fundamental analogy between humans and nonhumans. Some philosophers prefer to call such arguments “analogical,” and for good reason. But this is not sufficiently precise. Nearly every conceivable argument for panpsychism must start from the fact of our own human mind, and draw some analogy from that. It is the nature of the analogy that distinguishes the arguments. The continuity arguments are one particular form of analogical thinking, and hence deserve special designation.

In order to oppose an argument by continuity, one must either refute the existence of the substance or structure, or deny that it relates to mind in any fundamental way—the latter being the more common approach. The critic may argue that the continuity analogy simply fails to hold; hence we have the Inconclusive Analogy objection. Such a critic typically would take the extreme cases of a human versus a rock or an atom, and argue that no relevant analogy can be made. But of course, what seems obvious in the extreme cases is less so when one examines the intermediate points; it is there that the critic has to make his case.

A second general argument for panpsychism, also dating back to ancient Greece, relates to the notion of emergence of mind. The Greeks developed the idea that ex nihilo, nihil fit: out of nothing comes nothing. We thus get the argument that mind cannot arise from no-mind, and hence that mind must have been present at the very origin of things. This is the Argument from Non-Emergence. An extended treatment follows in Section 4.

The Non-Emergence Argument is countered by claiming, naturally, that emergence of mind is in fact intelligible and explicable (this is the majority view, but no philosopher to date has succeeded in giving a widely-accepted explanation for it). Popper (1977) was perhaps the first to use emergence as an objection to panpsychism, but recently an entire volume was dedicated to this topic; see Strawson, et al (2006).

With the advent of Darwin’s theory of evolution in the mid-1800’s there came new support for both continuity and non-emergence arguments. If humans evolved from lower animals, they from single-celled creatures, and they in turn from nonliving matter, then the continuity of beings suggests a continuity of the fundamental qualities of experience, awareness, and mind. Evolutionary continuity over time makes difficult any attempt to define the supposed point in history at which mind suddenly appeared. Haeckel (1892) was the first to offer an evolutionary argument, but Paulsen, Royce, Waddington, and Rensch made essentially the same claim.

Others expressed it differently. There is, they said, no place within the hierarchy of organism complexity—the so-called phylogenetic chain—where one can “draw a line” to distinguish those with mind from those without. Clifford (1874) was perhaps the first to put it this way:

[I]t is impossible for anybody to point out the particular place…where [absence of consciousness] can be supposed to have taken place. […] [E]ven in the very lowest organisms, even in the Amoeba…there is something or other, inconceivably simple to us, which is of the same nature with our own consciousness… [Furthermore] we cannot stop at organic matter, [but] we are obliged to assume…that along with every motion of matter, whether organic or inorganic, there is some fact which corresponds to the mental fact in ourselves (pp. 60-61).

Others, including Globus, Chalmers (1996), and Rensch, have argued in similar terms.

To counter this argument one must identify a plausible point at which to break the hierarchical chain. Where, and why, does the continuity suddenly fail to hold? All agree that it holds, to some degree, for higher mammals, such as chimpanzees and dolphins. If the critic believes it to fail with rocks and atoms, he must explain this discrepancy—otherwise the objection is invalid. To date few have attempted this. Tye (2000: 171) is one exception; he draws the line at fish and honey bees, which, he says, are the simplest beings that experience a kind of “phenomenal consciousness.” Whether his rationale for this line is acceptable is an open question.

Two final objections bear mentioning. First is the Not Testable, or No Signs, objection: there is no empirical evidence, nor any conceivable test, that could point to the presence of mind in lesser beings. McGinn (1997) and Seager (1995) have raised this point, among others. Yet it is hard to see what might actually count as valid evidence of mind. As Royce and Peirce have observed, simpler minds may appear to us as law-like phenomena. Analogy and rational thinking about metaphysical continuity are all we have to go on. Given the conceptual difficulty in determining, with certainty, the existence of minds in other human beings, one should not be surprised that definitive evidence of lesser minds is lacking. Certainly there is, we may say, an epistemological gap here, in that our knowledge is deficient; but this does not imply an ontological gap, that is, an absence of mind in other things.

Lastly we have the Combination Problem: If mind is supposed to exist in atoms or cells, then higher-order minds, such as humans have, must be some kind of combination or sum of these lesser minds. But it is inconceivable how such a summing would work and how it might account for the richness of experience that we all feel. Because panpsychism cannot account for higher mind, the objector says, it must be false.

We should first note that this is not an objection to panpsychism per se, but only to the particular theory that says that higher-order mind must be composed of lower-order mental elements. Granting this, there remains the general question of the relation between higher- and lower-order minds within the same being. As such, the Combination Problem may be better seen as a call for details.

The problem was first addressed by Leibniz in the late 1600’s. His panpsychist theory of monads allowed for a single dominant monad to unify the collective, and serve as the mind of the body. Kant, in an early work Dreams of a Spirit-Seer, criticized Leibniz’s theory and thus became the first to employ the Combination Problem against panpsychism. In 1890 William James raised the issue, in objection to Clifford’s “mind-stuff” form of panpsychism—though by 1909 he had changed his mind, and stopped viewing combination as an insurmountable hurdle. More recently Seager (1995) highlights the combination problem as one of particular importance, as do a number of contributors to Strawson, et al (2006).

4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism

The issue of emergence of mind is important because it is the mutually exclusive counterpart to panpsychism: either you are a panpsychist, or you are an emergentist. Either mind was present in things from the very beginning or it appeared (emerged) at some point in the history of evolution. If, however, emergence is inexplicable, or is less viable, then one is left with the panpsychist alternative. This line of reasoning, as mentioned above, is the argument from Non-Emergence.

To briefly recap the historical forms of this argument: it was first formulated by Epicurus circa 300 B.C.E. As we have seen, he argued that the mental quality called will could not arise from non-will, and therefore that the atoms from which everything was made had to possess a kind of will themselves. Will cannot emerge ex nihilo, and thus is present in the very constituents of matter.

Others were likewise convinced by this approach. Telesio held that “nothing can give what it does not possess,” and thus it is inconceivable that mind arises from no-mind. Patrizi believed, similarly, that nothing can be in the effect that is not in the cause; hence, the elements themselves must have life and soul, which they in turn grant to all things. In 1620 Campanella wrote: “If the animals are sentient…and sentience does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have” (in Dooley, 1995: 39).

The German panpsychists also found this argument compelling. Fechner argued that “animate beings cannot arise from inanimate.” Paulsen examined the question, “Whence did psychical life arise?” His answer: it did not arise, but was present at the origin of things. The sudden appearance of a mental realm “would be an absolute world-riddle; it would mean a creation out of nothing” (1892: 100).

The Non-Emergence argument resurfaced in the late twentieth century with the work of zoologist Sewall Wright. In his 1977 article “Panpsychism and Science” he argued that brute emergence of mind would be a kind of inexplicable miracle in the natural order of things: “Emergence of mind from no mind at all is sheer magic” (p. 82). Thomas Nagel flirted with this argument in his “Panpsychism” essay (1979), but opted not to follow through on all the implications.

The basic problem is this: emergence seems, at first glance, to be a reasonable enough idea, but when pressed for details it comes up sorely lacking. In fact, emergence of mind is very difficult to sensibly explain. Mind is not like five-fingered-ness, or warm-bloodedness. These things, which clearly did emerge, are ontologically unlike mind. They are simply reconfigurations of existing physical matter, whereas mind is of a different ontological order. It is too fundamental an aspect of existence to be comparable to ordinary biological structural features.

Furthermore, emergence of mind is not just some fact of the distant evolutionary past; it must recur every day, in, for example, the development of a human embryo. That is, if a human egg is utterly without mind, and a newborn infant has one, when in the ontogenetic process does mind emerge? Why just there? So in addition to the phylogenetic (historical) emergence problem, we have the related ontogenetic problem as well.

Given that there are very few panpsychists in the world, most everyone is an emergentist. But, as Galen Strawson (2006) has recently emphasized, emergentism is not a forgone conclusion. In fact, it is highly dubious. His piece “Realistic Monism: Why Physicalism Entails Panpsychism” presses this point with notable urgency, and offers the most detailed and complete version of the Non-Emergence argument to date. If one is not a panpsychist, then one necessarily believes that only some subset of creatures is privileged to possess mind. The vast remainder of nature, then, is utterly non-mental. This, Strawson observes, is pure presumption: “there is absolutely no evidence whatsoever” (p. 20) for a non-mental component of reality. We simply assume it to be so.

Strawson’s argument, in a nutshell, is this:

  • There is one ultimate reality to the universe (“realistic physicalism,” as he calls it).
  • Mental (that is, experiential) phenomena are a part of this monistic reality. Therefore, experiential phenomena are physical phenomena, rightly understood.
  • Radical-kind, or brute, emergence is impossible; mental phenomena cannot arise from any purely non-mental stuff.
  • Therefore, the one reality and all things in it are necessarily experiential.

If we are to be physicalists, Strawson says, then let us be real physicalists and take the implications seriously. When we do so, we find that “something akin to panpsychism is not merely one possible form of realistic physicalism, but the only possible form, and hence, the only possible form of physicalism tout court” (p. 9).

Strawson tackles head-on those who implicitly endorse emergence. He asks, “Does this conception of emergence make sense? I think that it is very, very hard to understand what it is supposed to involve. I think that it is incoherent, in fact, and that this general way of talking of emergence has acquired an air of plausibility…for some simply because it has been appealed to many times in the face of a seeming mystery” (p. 12). He gives a number of examples of putative emergence, showing that each is really unintelligible. His slogan: “emergence can’t be brute,” that is, higher-order mind can emerge from lower-order, but mind cannot possibly emerge from no-mind. “Brute emergence is by definition a miracle every time it occurs,” which is rationally inconceivable.

Panpsychism thus offers a kind of resolution to the problem of emergence, and is supported by several other arguments as well. The viability of panpsychism is no longer really in question. At issue is the specific form it might take, and what its implications are. Panpsychism suggests a radically different worldview, one that is fundamentally at odds with the dominant mechanistic conception of the universe. Arguably, it is precisely this mechanistic view—which sees the universe and everything in it as a kind of giant machine—that lies at the root of many of our philosophical, sociological, and environmental problems. Panpsychism, by challenging this worldview at its root, potentially offers new solutions to some very old problems.

5. References and Further Reading

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  • Chalmers, D. 1996. The Conscious Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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  • Cobb, J. B. Jr., and D. R. Griffin (Eds.). 1977. Mind in Nature. Washington DC: University of Press America.
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  • Griffin, D. R. 1998. Unsnarling the World Knot. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
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  • Haeckel, E. 1892. “Our Monism.” Monist, 2(4).
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  • Hartmann, E. von. 1869/1950. Philosophy of the Unconscious. Trans. W. Coupland. London: Routledge.
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  • Hartshorne, C. 1950. “Panpsychism.” In A History of Philosophical System. Ed. V. Ferm. New York: Philosophical Library.
  • Hartshorne, C. 1977. “Physics and Psychics.” In Mind in Nature. Eds. J. B. Cobb Jr. and D. R. Griffin. Washington DC: University Press of America.
  • Hartshorne, C. 1979. “The Rights of the Subhuman World.” Environmental Ethics, 1.
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  • James, W. 1909/1996. A Pluralistic Universe. Lincoln, NE: University of Nebraska Press.
  • Koestler, A. 1967. Ghost in the Machine. New York: Macmillan.
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  • Leibniz, G. 1989. Philosophical Essays. Eds. R. Ariew and D. Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett.
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  • Lucretius. Ca. 60 BCE/1977. De rerum natura (The Nature of Things). Trans. F. Copley. New York: W. W. Norton Publishing.
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  • Mathews, F. 2003. For Love of Matter. New York: SUNY Press.
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Author Information

David Skrbina
Email: skrbina@umd.umich.edu
University of Michigan at Dearborn
U. S. A.

Model-Theoretic Conceptions of
Logical Consequence

One sentence X is said to be a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in the set to be true without X being true as well. One well-known specification of this informal characterization is the model-theoretic conception of logical consequence: a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences if and only if all models of K are models of X. The model-theoretic characterization is a theoretical definition of logical consequence. It has been argued that this conception of logical consequence is more basic than the characterization in terms of deducibility in a deductive system. The correctness of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence, and the adequacy of the notion of a logical constant it utilizes are matters of contemporary debate.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Linguistic Preliminaries: the Language M
    1. Syntax of M
    2. Semantics for M
  3. What is a Logic?
  4. Model-Theoretic Consequence
    1. Truth in a structure
    2. Satisfaction revisited
    3. A formalized definition of truth for Language M
    4. Model-theoretic consequence defined
  5. The Status of the Model-Theoretic Characterization of Logical Consequence
    1. The model-theoretic characterization is a theoretical definition of logical consequence
    2. The common concept of logical consequence
    3. What is a logical constant?
  6. Conclusion
  7. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

One sentence X is said to be a logical consequence of a set of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in K to be true without X being true as well. One well-known specification of this informal characterization, due to Tarski (1936), is: X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language L according to which all the sentences in K are true and X is false. A possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of L according to which sentences are true or false is a reading of the non-logical terms according to which the sentences receive a truth-value (that is, are either true or false) in a situation that is not ruled out by the semantic properties of the logical constants. The philosophical locus of the technical development of ‘possible interpretation’ in terms of models is Tarski (1936). A model for a language L is the theoretical development of a possible interpretation of non-logical terminology of L according to which the sentences of L receive a truth-value. The characterization of logical consequence in terms of models is called the Tarskian or model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence. It may be stated as follows.

X is a logical consequence of K if and only if all models of K are models of X.

See the entry, Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations, for discussion of Tarski’s development of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence in light of the ordinary conception.

We begin by giving an interpreted language M. Next, logical consequence is defined model-theoretically. Finally, the status of this characterization is discussed, and criticisms of it are entertained.

2. Linguistic Preliminaries: the Language M

Here we define a simple language M, a language about the McKeon family, by first sketching what strings qualify as well-formed formulas (wffs) in M. Next we define sentences from formulas, and then give an account of truth in M, that is we describe the conditions in which M-sentences are true.

a. Syntax of M

Building blocks of formulas

Terms

Individual names—’beth’, ‘kelly’, ‘matt’, ‘paige’, ‘shannon’, ‘evan’, and ‘w1‘, ‘w2‘, ‘w3 ‘, etc.

Variables—’x’, ‘y’, ‘z’, ‘x1‘, ‘y1 ‘, ‘z1‘, ‘x2‘, ‘y2‘, ‘z2‘, etc.

Predicates

1-place predicates—’Female’, ‘Male’

2-place predicates—’Parent’, ‘Brother’, ‘Sister’, ‘Married’, ‘OlderThan’, ‘Admires’, ‘=’.

Blueprints of well-formed formulas (wffs)

Atomic formulas: An atomic wff is any of the above n-place predicates followed by n terms which are enclosed in parentheses and separated by commas.

Formulas: The general notion of a well-formed formula (wff) is defined recursively as follows:

(1) All atomic wffs are wffs.
(2) If α is a wff, so is ''.
(3) If α and β are wffs, so is '(α & β)'.
(4) If α and β are wffs, so is 'v β)'.
(5) If α and β are wffs, so is '(α → β)'.
(6) If Ψ is a wff and v is a variable, then 'vΨ' is a wff.
(7) If Ψ is a wff and v is a variable, then 'vΨ' is a wff.
Finally, no string of symbols is a well-formed formula of M unless the string can be derived from (1)-(7).

The signs ‘~’, ‘&’, ‘v‘, and ‘→’, are called sentential connectives. The signs ‘∀’ and ‘∃’ are called quantifiers.

It will prove convenient to have available in M an infinite number of individual names as well as variables. The strings ‘Parent(beth, paige)’ and ‘Male(x)’ are examples of atomic wffs. We allow the identity symbol in an atomic formula to occur in between two terms, e.g., instead of ‘=(evan, evan)’ we allow ‘(evan = evan)’. The symbols ‘~’, ‘&’, ‘v‘, and ‘→’ correspond to the English words ‘not’, ‘and’, ‘or’ and ‘if…then’, respectively. ‘∃’ is our symbol for an existential quantifier and ‘∀’ represents the universal quantifier. 'vΨ' and 'vΨ' correspond to for some v, Ψ, and for all v, Ψ, respectively. For every quantifier, its scope is the smallest part of the wff in which it is contained that is itself a wff. An occurrence of a variable v is a bound occurrence iff it is in the scope of some quantifier of the form 'v' or the form 'v', and is free otherwise. For example, the occurrence of ‘x’ is free in ‘Male(x)’ and in ‘∃y Married(y, x)’. The occurrences of ‘y’ in the second formula are bound because they are in the scope of the existential quantifier. A wff with at least one free variable is an open wff, and a closed formula is one with no free variables. A sentence is a closed wff. For example, ‘Female(kelly)’ and ‘∃y∃x Married(y, x)’ are sentences but ‘OlderThan(kelly, y)’ and ‘(∃x Male(x) & Female(z))’ are not. So, not all of the wffs of M are sentences. As noted below, this will affect our definition of truth for M.

b. Semantics for M

We now provide a semantics for M. This is done in two steps. First, we specify a domain of discourse, that is, the chunk of the world that our language M is about, and interpret M’s predicates and names in terms of the elements composing the domain. Then we state the conditions under which each type of M-sentence is true. To each of the above syntactic rules (1-7) there corresponds a semantic rule that stipulates the conditions in which the sentence constructed using the syntactic rule is true. The principle of bivalence is assumed and so ‘not true’ and ‘false’ are used interchangeably. In effect, the interpretation of M determines a truth-value (true, false) for each and every sentence of M.

Domain D—The McKeons: Matt, Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige, and Evan.

Here are the referents and extensions of the names and predicates of M.

Terms: ‘matt’ refers to Matt, ‘beth’ refers to Beth, ‘shannon’ refers to Shannon, etc.

Predicates. The meaning of a predicate is identified with its extension, that is the set (possibly empty) of elements from the domain D the predicate is true of. The extension of a one-place predicate is a set of elements from D, the extension of a two-place predicate is a set of ordered pairs of elements from D.

The extension of ‘Male’ is {Matt, Evan}.

The extension of ‘Female’ is {Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige}.

The extension of ‘Parent’ is {<Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Married’ is {<Matt, Beth>, <Beth, Matt>}.

The extension of ‘Sister’ is {<Shannon, Kelly>, <Kelly, Shannon>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Paige, Shannon>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Paige, Kelly>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>, <Shannon, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Brother’ is {<Evan, Shannon>, <Evan, Kelly>, <Evan, Paige>}.

The extension of ‘OlderThan’ is {<Beth, Matt>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>, <Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Shannon, Kelly>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Shannon, Evan>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Admires’ is {<Matt, Beth>, <Shannon, Matt>, <Shannon, Beth>, <Kelly, Beth>, <Kelly, Matt>, <Kelly, Shannon>, <Paige, Beth>, <Paige, Matt>, <Paige, Shannon>, <Paige, Kelly>, <Evan, Beth>, <Evan, Matt>, <Evan, Shannon>, <Evan, Kelly>, <Evan, Paige>}.

The extension of ‘=’ is {<Matt, Matt>, <Beth, Beth>, <Shannon, Shannon>, <Kelly, Kelly>, <Paige, Paige>, <Evan, Evan>}.

(I) An atomic sentence with a one-place predicate is true iff the referent of the term is a member of the extension of the predicate, and an atomic sentence with a two-place predicate is true iff the ordered pair formed from the referents of the terms in order is a member of the extension of the predicate.

The atomic sentence ‘Female(kelly)’ is true because, as indicated above, the referent of ‘kelly’ is in the extension of the property designated by ‘Female’. The atomic sentence ‘Married(shannon, kelly)’ is false because the ordered pair <Shannon, Kelly> is not in the extension of the relation designated by ‘Married’.

Let α and β be any M-sentences.

(II) '' is true iff α is false.
(III) '(α & β)' is true when both α and β are true; otherwise '(α & β)' is false.
(IV) 'v β)' is true when at least one of α and β is true; otherwise 'v β)' is false.
(V) '(α → β)' is true if and only if (iff) α is false or β is true. So, '(α → β)' is false just in case α is true and β is false.

The meanings for ‘~’ and ‘&’ roughly correspond to the meanings of ‘not’ and ‘and’ as ordinarily used. We call '' and '(α & β)' negation and conjunction formulas, respectively. The formula '(~α v β)' is called a disjunction and the meaning of ‘v‘ corresponds to inclusive or. There are a variety of conditionals in English (e.g., causal, counterfactual, logical), each type having a distinct meaning. The conditional defined by (V) above is called the material conditional. One way of following (V) is to see that the truth conditions for '(α → β)' are the same as for '~(α & ~β)'.

By (II) ‘~Married(shannon, kelly)’ is true because, as noted above, ‘Married(shannon, kelly)’ is false. (II) also tells us that ‘~Female(kelly)’ is false since ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. According to (III), ‘(~Married(shannon, kelly) & Female(kelly))’ is true because ‘~Married(shannon, kelly)’ is true and ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. And ‘(Male(shannon) & Female(shannon))’ is false because ‘Male(shannon)’ is false. (IV) confirms that ‘(Female(kelly) v Married(evan, evan))’ is true because, even though ‘Married(evan, evan)’ is false, ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. From (V) we know that the sentence ‘(~(beth = beth) → Male(shannon))’ is true because ‘~(beth = beth)’ is false. If α is false then '(α → β)' is true regardless of whether or not β is true. The sentence ‘(Female(beth) → Male(shannon))’ is false because ‘Female(beth)’ is true and ‘Male(shannon)’ is false.

Before describing the truth conditions for quantified sentences we need to say something about the notion of satisfaction. We’ve defined truth only for the formulas of M that are sentences. So, the notions of truth and falsity are not applicable to non-sentences such as ‘Male(x)’ and ‘((x = x) → Female(x))’ in which ‘x’ occurs free. However, objects may satisfy wffs that are non-sentences. We introduce the notion of satisfaction with some examples. An object satisfies ‘Male(x)’ just in case that object is male. Matt satisfies ‘Male(x)’, Beth does not. This is the case because replacing ‘x’ in ‘Male(x)’ with ‘matt’ yields a truth while replacing the variable with ‘beth’ yields a falsehood. An object satisfies ‘((x = x) → Female(x))’ if and only if it is either not identical with itself or is a female. Beth satisfies this wff (we get a truth when ‘beth’ is substituted for the variable in all of its occurrences), Matt does not (putting ‘matt’ in for ‘x’ wherever it occurs results in a falsehood). As a first approximation, we say that an object with a name, say ‘a’, satisfies a wff 'Ψv' in which at most v occurs free if and only if the sentence that results by replacing v in all of its occurrences with ‘a’ is true. ‘Male(x)’ is neither true nor false because it is not a sentence, but it is either satisfiable or not by a given object. Now we define the truth conditions for quantifications, utilizing the notion of satisfaction. The notion of satisfaction will be revisited below when we formalize the semantics for M and give the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence.

Let Ψ be any formula of M in which at most v occurs free.

(VI) 'vΨ' is true just in case there is at least one individual in the domain of quantification (e.g. at least one McKeon) that satisfies Ψ.
(VII) 'vΨ' is true just in case every individual in the domain of quantification (e.g. every McKeon) satisfies Ψ.

Here are some examples. ‘∃x(Male(x) & Married(x, beth))’ is true because Matt satisfies ‘(Male(x) & Married(x, beth))’; replacing ‘x’ wherever it appears in the wff with ‘matt’ results in a true sentence. The sentence ‘∃xOlderThan(x, x)’ is false because no McKeon satisfies ‘OlderThan(x, x)’, that is replacing ‘x’ in ‘OlderThan(x, x)’ with the name of a McKeon always yields a falsehood.

The universal quantification ‘∀x( OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’ is false for there is a McKeon who doesn’t satisfy ‘(OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’. For example, Shannon does not satisfy ‘(OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’ because Shannon satisfies ‘OlderThan(x, paige)’ but not ‘Male(x)’. The sentence ‘∀x(x = x)’ is true because all McKeons satisfy ‘x = x’; replacing ‘x’ with the name of any McKeon results in a true sentence.

Note that in the explanation of satisfaction we suppose that an object satisfies a wff only if the object is named. But we don’t want to presuppose that all objects in the domain of discourse are named. For the purposes of an example, suppose that the McKeons adopt a baby boy, but haven’t named him yet. Then, ‘∃x Brother(x, evan)’ is true because the adopted child satisfies ‘Brother(x, evan)’, even though we can’t replace ‘x’ with the child’s name to get a truth. To get around this is easy enough. We have added a list of names, ‘w1‘, ‘w2‘, ‘w3‘, etc., to M, and we may say that any unnamed object satisfies 'Ψv' iff the replacement of v with a previously unused wi assigned as a name of this object results in a true sentence. In the above scenerio, ‘∃xBrother(x, evan)’ is true because, ultimately, treating ‘w1‘ as a temporary name of the child, ‘Brother(w1, evan)’ is true. Of course, the meanings of the predicates would have to be amended in order to reflect the addition of a new person to the domain of McKeons.

3. What is a Logic?

We have characterized an interpreted formal language M by defining what qualifies as a sentence of M and by specifying the conditions under which any M-sentence is true. The received view of logical consequence entails that the logical consequence relation in M turns on the nature of the logical constants in the relevant M-sentences. We shall regard just the sentential connectives, the quantifiers of M, and the identity predicate as logical constants (the language M is a first-order language). For discussion of the notion of a logical constant see Section 5c below.

At the start of this article, it is said that a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in K to be true without X being true as well. A model-theoretic conception of logical consequence in language M clarifies this intuitive characterization of logical consequence by appealing to the semantic properties of the logical constants, represented in the above truth clauses (I)-(VII). In contrast, a deductive-theoretic conception clarifies logical consequence in M, conceived of in terms of deducibility, by appealing to the inferential properties of logical constants portrayed as intuitively valid principles of inference, that is, principles justifying steps in deductions. See Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions for a deductive-theoretic characterization of logical consequence in terms of a deductive system, and for a discussion on the relationship between the logical consequence relation and the model-theoretic and deductive-theoretic conceptions of it.

Following Shapiro (1991, p. 3), we define a logic to be a formal language L plus either a model-theoretic or a deductive-theoretic account of logical consequence. A language with both characterizations is a full logic just in case the two characterizations coincide. The logic for M developed below may be viewed as a classical logic or a first-order theory.

4. Model-Theoretic Consequence

The technical machinery to follow is designed to clarify how it is that sentences receive truth-values owing to interpretations of them. We begin by introducing the notion of a structure. Then we revisit the notion of satisfaction in order to make it more precise, and link structures and satisfaction to model-theoretic consequence. We offer a modernized version of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence sketched by Tarski and so deviate from the details of Tarski’s presentation in his (1936).

a. Truth in a structure

Relative to our language M, a structure U is an ordered pair <D, I>.

(1) D, a non-empty set of elements, is the domain of discourse. Two things to highlight here. First, the domain D of a structure for M may be any set of entities, e.g. the dogs living in Connecticut, the toothbrushes on Earth, the natural numbers, the twelve apostles, etc. Second, we require that D not be the empty set.
(2) I is a function that assigns to each individual constant of M an element of D, and to each n-place predicate of M a subset of Dn (that is, the set of n-tuples taken from D). In essence, I interprets the individual constants and predicates of M, linking them to elements and sets of n-tuples of elements from of D. For individual constants c and predicates P, the element IU(c) is the element of D designated by c under IU, and IU(P) is the set of entities assigned by IU as the extension of P.

By ‘structure’ we mean an L-structure for some first-order language L. The intended structure for a language L is the course-grained representation of the piece of the world that we intend L to be about. The intended domain D and its subsets represent the chunk of the world L is being used to talk about and quantify over. The intended interpretation of L’s constants and predicates assigns the actual denotations to L’s constants and the actual extensions to the predicates. The above semantics for our language M, may be viewed, in part, as an informal portrayal of the intended structure of M, which we refer to as UM. That is, we take M to be a tool for talking about the McKeon family with respect to gender, who is older than whom, who admires whom, etc. To make things formally prim and proper we should represent the interpretation of constants as IUM(matt) = Matt, IUM(beth) = Beth, and so on. And the interpretation of predicates can look like IUM(Male) = {Matt, Evan}, IUM(Female) = {Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige}, and so on. We assume that this has been done.

A structure U for a language L (that is, an L-structure) represents one way that a language can be used to talk about a state of affairs. Crudely, the domain D and the subsets recovered from D constitute a rudimentary representation of a state of affairs, and the interpretation of L’s predicates and individual constants makes the language L about the relevant state of affairs. Since a language can be assigned different structures, it can be used to talk about different states of affairs. The class of L-structures represents all the states of affairs that the language L can be used to talk about. For example, consider the following M-structure U’.

D = the set of natural numbers

IU’(beth) = 2
IU’(matt) = 3
IU’(shannon) = 5
IU’(kelly) = 7
IU’(paige) = 11
IU’(evan) = 10
I U’(Male) = {d ∈ D | d is prime}
I U’(Female) = {d ∈ D | d is even}
I U’(Parent) = ∅
I U’(Married) = {<d, d’> ∈ D2 | d + 1 = d’ }
I U’(Sister) = ∅
I U’(Brother) = {<d, d’> ∈ D2 | d < d’ }
I U’(OlderThan) = {<d, d’> ∈ D2 | d > d’ }
I U’(Admires) = ∅
I U’(=) = {<d, d’> ∈ D2 | d = d’ }

 

In specifying the domain D and the values of the interpretation function defined on M’s predicates we make use of brace notation, instead of the earlier list notation, to pick out sets. For example, we write

{d ∈ D | d is even}

to say “the set of all elements d of D such that d is even.” And

{<d, d’> ∈ D2 | d > d’}

reads: “The set of ordered pairs of elements d, d’ of D such that d > d’.” Consider: the sentence

OlderThan(beth, matt)

is true in the intended structure UM for <IUM(beth), IUM(matt)> is in IUM(OlderThan). But the sentence is false in U’ for <IU’(beth), IU’(matt)> is not in IU’(OlderThan) (because 2 is not greater than 3). The sentence

(Female(beth) & Male(beth))

is not true in UM but is true in U’ for IU’(beth) is in IU’(Female) and in IU’(Male) (because 2 is an even prime). In order to avoid confusion it is worth highlighting that when we say that the sentence ‘(Female(beth) & Male(beth))’ is true in one structure and false in another we are saying that one and the same wff with no free variables is true in one state of affairs on an interpretation and false in another state of affairs on another interpretation.

b. Satisfaction revisited

Note the general strategy of giving the semantics of the sentential connectives: the truth of a compound sentence formed with any of them is determined by its component well-formed formulas (wffs), which are themselves (simpler) sentences. However, this strategy needs to be altered when it comes to quantificational sentences. For quantificational sentences are built out of open wffs and, as noted above, these component wffs do not admit of truth and falsity. Therefore, we can’t think of the truth of, say,

∃x(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, paige))

in terms of the truth of ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, paige))’ for some McKeon x. What we need is a truth-relevant property of open formulas that we may appeal to in explaining the truth-value of the compound quantifications formed from them. Tarski is credited with the solution, first hinted at in the following.

The possibility suggests itself, however, of introducing a more general concept which is applicable to any sentential function [open or closed wff] can be recursively defined, and, when applied to sentences leads us directly to the concept of truth. These requirements are met by the notion of satisfaction of a given sentential function by given objects. (Tarski 1933, p. 189)

The needed property is satisfaction. The truth of the above existential quantification will depend on there being an object that satisfies both ‘Female(x)’ and ‘OlderThan(x, paige)’. Earlier we introduced the concept of satisfaction by describing the conditions in which one element satisfies an open formula with one free variable. Now we want to develop a picture of what it means for objects to satisfy a wff with n free variables for any n ≥ 0. We begin by introducing the notion of a variable assignment.

A variable assignment is a function g from a set of variables (its domain) to a set of objects (its range). We shall say that the variable assignment g is suitable for a well-formed formula (wff) Ψ of M if every free variable in Ψ is in the domain of g. In order for a variable assignment to satisfy a wff it must be suitable for the formula. For a variable assignment g that is suitable for Ψ, g satisfies Ψ in U iff the object(s) g assigns to the free variable(s) in Ψ satisfy Ψ. Unlike the earlier first-step characterization of satisfaction, there is no appeal to names for the entities assigned to the variables. This has the advantage of not requiring that new names be added to a language that does not have names for everything in the domain. In specifying a variable assignment g, we write α/v, β/v’, χ/v”, … to indicate that g(v) = α, g(v’ ) = β, g(v” ) = χ, etc. We understand

U ⊨ Ψ[g]

to mean that g satisfies Ψ in U.

UM ⊨ OlderThan(x, y)[Shannon/x, Paige/y]

This is true: the variable assignment g, identified with [Shannon/x, Paige/y], satisfies ‘Olderthan(x, y)’ because Shannon is older than Paige.

UM ⊨ Admires(x, y)[Beth/x, Matt/y]

This is false for this variable assignment does not satisfy the wff: Beth does not admire Matt. However, the following is true because Matt admires Beth.

UM ⊨ Admires(x, y)[Matt/x, Beth/y]

For any wff Ψ, a suitable variable assignment g and structure U together ensure that the terms in Ψ designate elements in D. The structure U insures that individual constants have referents, and the assignment g insures that any free variables in Ψ get denotations. For any individual constant c, c[g] is the element IU(c). For each variable v, and assignment g whose domain contains v, v[g] is the element g(v). In effect, the variable assignment treats the variable v as a temporary name. We define t[g] as ‘the element designated by t relative to the assignment g’.

c. A formalized definition of truth for Language M

We now give a definition of truth for the language M via the detour through satisfaction. The goal is to define for each formula α of M and each assignment g to the free variables, if any, of α in U what must obtain in order for U ⊨ α[g].

(I) Where R is an n-place predicate and t1, …, tn are terms, UR(t1, …, tn)[g] if and only if (iff) the n-tuple <t1[g], …, tn[g]> is in IU(R).
(II) U ⊨ ~α[g] iff it is not true that U ⊨ α[g].
(III) U ⊨ (α & β)[g] iff U ⊨ α[g] and U ⊨ β[g].
(IV) U ⊨ (α v β)[g] iff U ⊨ α[g] or U ⊨ β[g].
(V) U ⊨ (α → β)[g] iff either it is not true that U ⊨ α[g] or U ⊨ β[g].

Before going on to the (VI) and (VII) clauses for quantificational sentences, it is worthwhile to introduce the notion of a variable assignment that comes from another. Consider

∃y(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)).

We want to say that a variable assignment g satisfies this wff if and only if there is a variable assignment g’ differing from g at most with regard to the object it assigns to the variable y such that g’ satisfies ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y))’. We say that a variable assignment g’ comes from an assignment g when the domain of g’ is that of g and a variable v, and g’ assigns the same values as g with the possible exception of the element g’ assigns to v. In general, we represent an extension g’ of an assignment g as follows.

[g, d/v]

This picks out a variable assignment g’ which differs at most from g in that v is in its domain and g'(v) = d, for some element d of the domain D. So, it is true that

UM ⊨∃y(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)) [Beth/x]

since

UM ⊨ (Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)) [Beth/x, Paige/y].

What this says is that the variable assignment that comes from the assignment of Beth to ‘x’ by adding the assignment of Paige to ‘y’ satisfies ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y))’ in UM. This is true for Beth is a female who is older than Paige. Now we give the satisfaction clauses for quantificational sentences. Let Ψ be any formula of M.

(VI) U ⊨∃vΨ[g] iff for at least one element d of D, U ⊨ Ψ[g, d/v].
(VII) U ⊨ ∀vΨ[g] iff for all elements d of D, U ⊨ Ψ[g, d/v].

If α is a sentence, then it has no free variables and we write U ⊨ α[g] which says that the empty variable assignment satisfies α in U. The empty variable assignment g does not assign objects to any variables. In short: the definition of truth for language L is

A sentence α is true in U if and only if U ⊨ α[g], that is the empty variable assignment satisfies α in U.

The truth definition specifies the conditions in which a formula of M is true in a structure by explaining how the semantic properties of any formula of M are determined by its construction from semantically primitive expressions (e.g., predicates, individual constants, and variables) whose semantic properties are specified directly. If every member of a set of sentences is true in a structure U we say that U is a model of the set. We now work through some examples. The reader will be aided by referring when needed to the clauses (I)-(VII).

It is true that UM ⊨ ~Married(kelly, kelly))[g], that is, by (II) it is not true that UM ⊨ Married(kelly, kelly))[g], because <kelly[g], kelly[g]> is not in IUM(Married). Hence, by (IV)

UM ⊨ (Married(shannon, kelly) v ~Married(kelly, kelly))[g].

Our truth definition should confirm that

∃x∃y Admires(x, y)

is true in UM. Note that by (VI) UM ⊨∃yAdmires(x, y)[g, Paige/x] since UM ⊨ Admires(x, y)[g, Paige/x, kelly/y]. Hence, by (VI)

UM ⊨∃x∃y Admires(x, y)[g] .

The sentence, ‘∀x∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))’ is true in UM . By (VII) we know that

UM ⊨ ∀x∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g]

if and only if

for all elements d of D, UM ⊨∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g, d/x].

This is true. For each element d and assignment [g, d/x], UM ⊨ (Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g, d/x, d’/y], that is, there is some element d’ and variable assignment g differing from [g, d/x] only in assigning d’ to ‘y’, such that g satisfies ‘(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))’ in UM .

d. Model-theoretic consequence defined

For any set K of M-sentences and M-sentence X, we write

K ⊨ X

to mean that every M-structure that is a model of K is also a model of X, that is, X is a model-theoretic consequence of K.

(1) OlderThan(paige, matt)
(2) ∀x(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))

Note that both (1) and (2) are false in the intended structure UM . We show that (2) is not a model theoretic consequence of (1) by describing a structure which is a model of (1) but not (2). The above structure U’ will do the trick. By (I) it is true that U’ ⊨ OlderThan(paige, matt)[g] because <(paige)[g], (matt)[g]> is in IU’(OlderThan) (because 11 is greater than 3). But, by (VII), it is not the case that

U’ ⊨ ∀x(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))[g]

since the variable assignment [g, 13/x] doesn’t satisfy ‘(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))’ in U’ according to (V) for U’ ⊨ Male(x)[g, 13/x] but not U’ ⊨ OlderThan(paige, x))[g, 13/x]. So, (2) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (1). Consider the following sentences.

(3) (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(paige, kelly))
(4) (Admires(paige, kelly) → Admires(kelly, beth))
(5) (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(kelly, beth))

(5) is a model-theoretic consequence of (3) and (4). For assume otherwise. That is assume, that there is a structure U” such that

(i) U” ⊨ (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(paige, kelly))[g]

and

(ii) U” ⊨ (Admires(paige, kelly) → Admires(kelly, beth))[g]

but not

(iii) U” ⊨ (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(kelly, beth))[g].

By (V), from the assumption that (iii) is false, it follows that U” ⊨ Admires(evan, paige)[g] and not U” ⊨ Admires(kelly, beth)[g]. Given the former, in order for (i) to hold according to (V) it must be the case that U” ⊨ Admires(paige, kelly))[g]. But then it is true that U” ⊨ Admires(paige, kelly))[g] and false that U” ⊨ Admires(kelly, beth)[g], which, again appealing to (V), contradicts our assumption (ii). Hence, there is no such U”, and so (5) is a model-theoretic consequence of (3) and (4).

Here are some more examples of the model-theoretic consequence relation in action.

(6) ∃xMale(x)
(7) ∃xBrother(x, shannon)
(8) ∃x(Male(x) & Brother(x, shannon))

(8) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (6) and (7). Consider the following structure U”’.

D = {1, 2, 3}

For all M-individual constants c, IU”’(c) = 1.

IU”’(Male) = {2}, IU”’(Brother) = {<3, 1>}. For all other M-predicates P, IU”’(P) = ∅.

Appealing to the satisfaction clauses (I), (III), and (VI), it is fairly straightforward to see that the structure U”’ is a model of (6) and (7) but not of (8). For example, U”’ is not a model of (8) for there is no element d of D and assignment [d/x] such that

U”’ ⊨ (Male(x) & Brother(x, shannon))[g, d/x].

Consider the following two sentences

(9) Female(shannon)
(10) ∃x Female(x)

(10) is a model-theoretic consequence of (9). For an arbitrary M-structure U, if U ⊨ Female(shannon)[g], then by satisfaction clause (I), shannon[g] is in IU(Female), and so there is at least one element of D, shannon[g], in IU(Female). Consequently, by (VI), U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g].

For a sentence X of M, we write

⊨ X.

to mean that X is a model-theoretic consequence of the empty set of sentences. This means that every M-structure is a model of X. Such sentences represent logical truths; it is not logically possible for them to be false. For example,

⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))

is true. Here’s one explanation why. Let U be an arbitrary M-structure. We now show that

U ⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))[g].

If U ⊨ ∀x Male(x) [g] holds, then by (VII) for every element d of the domain D, U ⊨ Male(x)[g, d/x]. But we know that D is non-empty, by the requirements on structures (see the beginning of Section 4.1), and so D has at least one element d. Hence for at least one element d of D, U ⊨ Male(x)[g, d/x], that is by (VI), U ⊨∃x Male(x))[g]. So, if U ⊨ (∀x Male(x)[g] then U ⊨∃x Male(x))[g], and, therefore according to (V),

U ⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))[g].

Since U is arbitrary, this establishes

⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x)).

If we treat ‘=’ as a logical constant and require that for all M-structures U, IU(=) = {<d, d’> ∈ D2| d = d’}, then M-sentences asserting that identity is reflexive, symmetrical, and transitive are true in every M-structure, that is the following hold.

⊨ ∀x(x = x)
⊨ ∀x∀y((x = y) → (y = x))
⊨ ∀x∀y∀z(((x = y) & (y = z)) → (x = z))

Structures which assign {<d, d’> ∈ D2| d = d’} to the identity symbol are sometimes called normal models. Letting 'Ψ(v)' be any wff in which just variable v occurs free,

∀x∀y((x = y) → (Ψ(x) → Ψ(y)))

is an instance of the principle that identicals are indiscernible—if x = y then whatever holds of x holds of y—and it is true in every M-structure U that is a normal model. Treating ‘=’ as a logical constant (which is standard) requires that we restrict the class of M-structures appealed to in the above model-theoretic definition of logical consequence to those that are normal models.

5. The Status of the Model-Theoretic Characterization of Logical Consequence

Logical consequence in language M has been defined in terms of the model-theoretic consequence relation. What is the status of this definition? We answered this question in part in Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions: Section 5a. by highlighting Tarski’s argument for holding that the model-theoretic conception of logical consequence is more basic than any deductive-system account of it. Tarski points to the fact that there are languages for which valid principles of inference can’t be represented in a deductive-system, but the logical consequence relation they determine can be represented model-theoretically. In what follows, we identify the type of definition the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence is, and then discuss its adequacy.

a. The model-theoretic characterization is a theoretical definition of logical consequence

In order to determine the success of the model-theoretic characterization, we need to know what type of definition it is. Clearly it is not intended as a lexical definition. As Tarski’s opening passage in his (1936) makes clear, a theory of logical consequence need not yield a report of what ‘logical consequence’ means. On other hand, it is clear that Tarski doesn’t see himself as offering just a stipulative definition. Tarski is not merely stating how he proposes to use ‘logical consequence’ and ‘logical truth’ (but see Tarski 1986) any more than Newton was just proposing how to use certain words when he defined force in terms of mass and acceleration. Newton was invoking a fundamental conceptual relationship in order to improve our understanding of the physical world. Similarly, Tarski’s definition of ‘logical consequence’ in terms of model-theoretic consequence is supposed to help us formulate a theory of logical consequence that deepens our understanding of what Tarski calls the common concept of logical consequence. Tarski thinks that the logical consequence relation is commonly regarded as necessary, formal, and a priori . As Tarski (1936, p. 409) says, “The concept of logical consequence is one of those whose introduction into a field of strict formal investigation was not a matter of arbitrary decision on the part of this or that investigator; in defining this concept efforts were made to adhere to the common usage of the language of everyday life.”

Let’s follow this approach in Tarski’s (1936) and treat the model-theoretic definition as a theoretical definition of ‘logical consequence’. The questions raised are whether the Tarskian model-theoretic definition of logical consequence leads to a good theory and whether it improves our understanding of logical consequence. In order to sketch a framework for thinking about this question, we review the key moves in the Tarskian analysis. In what follows, K is an arbitrary set of sentences from a language L, and X is any sentence from L. First, Tarski observes what he takes to be the commonly regarded features of logical consequence (necessity, formality, and a prioricity) and makes the following claim.

(1) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if (a) it is not possible for all the K to be true and X false, (b) this is due to the forms of the sentences, and (c) this is known a priori.

Tarski’s deep insight was to see the criteria, listed in bold, in terms of the technical notion of truth in a structure. The key step in his analysis is to embody the above criteria (a)-(c) in terms of the notion of a possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology in sentences. Substituting for what is in bold in (1) we get

(2) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language according to which all the sentences in K are true and X is false.

The third step of the Tarskian analysis of logical consequence is to use the technical notion of truth in a structure or model to capture the idea of a possible interpretation. That is, we understand there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language according to which all of the sentences in K are true and X is false in terms of: Every model of K is a model of X, that is, K ⊨ X.

To elaborate, as reflected in (2), the analysis turns on a selection of terms as logical constants. This is represented model-theoretically by allowing the interpretation of the non-logical terminology to change from one structure to another, and by making the interpretation of the logical constants invariant across the class of structures. Then, relative to a set of terms treated as logical, the Tarskian, model-theoretic analysis is committed to

(3) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if K ⊨ X.

and

(4) X is a logical truth, that is, it is logically impossible for X to be false, if and only if ⊨ X.

As a theoretical definition, we expect the ⊨-relation to reflect the essential features of the common concept of logical consequence. By Tarski’s lights, the ⊨-consequence relation should be necessary, formal, and a priori. Note that model theory by itself does not provide the means for drawing a boundary between the logical and the non-logical. Indeed, its use presupposes that a list of logical terms is in hand. For example, taking Sister and Female to be logical constants, the consequence relation from (A) ‘Sister(kelly, paige)’ to (B) ‘Female(kelly)’ is necessary, formal and a priori. So perhaps (B) should be a logical consequence of (A). The fact that (B) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (A) is due to the fact that the interpretation of the two predicates can vary from one structure to another. To remedy this we could make the interpretation of the two predicates invariant so that ‘∀x(∃y Sister(x, y) → Female(x))’ is true in all structures, and, therefore if (A) is true in a structure, (B) is too. The point here is that the use of models to capture the logical consequence relation requires a prior choice of what terms to treat as logical. This is, in turn, reflected in the identification of the terms whose interpretation is constant from one structure to another.

So in assessing the success of the Tarskian model-theoretic definition of logical consequence for a language L, two issues arise. First, does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence? Second, is the boundary in L between logical and non-logical terms correctly drawn? In other words: what in L qualifies as a logical constant? Both questions are motivated by the adequacy criteria for theoretical definitions of logical consequence. They are central questions in the philosophy of logic and their significance is at least partly due to the prevalent use of model theory in logic to represent logical consequence in a variety of languages. In what follows, I sketch some responses to the two questions that draw on contemporary work in philosophy of logic. I begin with the first question.

b. Does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence?

The ⊨-consequence relation is formal. Also, a brief inspection of the above justifications that K ⊨ X obtain for given K and X reveals that the ⊨-consequence relation is a priori. Does the ⊨-consequence relation capture the modal element in the common concept of logical consequence? There are critics who argue that the model-theoretic account lacks the conceptual resources to rule out the possibility of there being logically possible situations in which sentences in K are true and X is false but no structure U such that U ⊨ K and not U ⊨ X. Kneale (1961) is an early critic, and Etchemendy (1988, 1999) offers a sustained and multi-faceted attack. We follow Etchemendy. Consider the following three sentences.

(1) (Female(shannon) & ~Married(shannon, matt))
(2) (~Female(matt) & Married(beth, matt))
(3) ~Female(beth)

(3) is neither a logical nor a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2). However, in order for a structure to make (1) and (2) true but not (3) its domain must have at least three elements. If the world contained, say, just two things, then there would be no such structure and (3) would be a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2). But in this scenario, (3) would not be a logical consequence of (1) and (2) because it would still be logically possible for the world to be larger and in such a possible situation (1) and (2) can be interpreted true and (3) false. The problem raised for the model-theoretic account of logical consequence is that we do not think that the class of logically possible situations varies under different assumptions as to the cardinality of the world’s elements. But the class of structures surely does since they are composed of worldly elements. This is a tricky criticism. Let’s look at it from a slightly different vantagepoint.

We might think that the extension of the logical consequence relation for an interpreted language such as our language M about the McKeons is necessary. For example, it can’t be the case that for some K and X, even though X isn’t a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, X could be. So, on the supposition that the world contains less, the extension of the logical consequence relation should not expand. However, the extension of the model-theoretic consequence does expand. For example, (3) is not, in fact, a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2), but it would be if there were just two things. This is evidence that the model-theoretic characterization has failed to capture the modal notion inherent in the common concept of logical consequence.

In defense of Tarski (see Ray 1999 and Sher 1991 for defenses of the Tarskian analysis against Etchemendy), one might question the force of the criticism because it rests on the supposition that it is possible for there to be just finitely many things. How could there be just two things? Indeed, if we countenance an infinite totality of necessary existents such as abstract objects (e.g., pure sets), then the class of structures will be fixed relative to an infinite collection of necessary existents, and the above criticism that turns on it being possible that there are just n things for finite n doesn’t go through (for discussion see McGee 1999). One could reply that while it is metaphysically impossible for there to be merely finitely many things it is nevertheless logically possible and this is relevant to the modal notion in the concept of logical consequence. This reply requires the existence of primitive, basic intuitions regarding the logical possibility of there being just finitely many things. However, intuitions about possible cardinalities of worldly individuals—not informed by mathematics and science—tend to run stale. Consequently, it is hard to debate this reply: one either has the needed logical intuitions, or not.

What is clear is that our knowledge of what is a model-theoretic consequence of what in a given L depends on our knowledge of the class of L-structures. Since such structures are furniture of the world, our knowledge of the model-theoretic consequence relation is grounded on knowledge of substantive facts about the world. Even if such knowledge is a priori, it is far from obvious that our a priori knowledge of the logical consequence relation is so substantive. One might argue that knowledge of what follows from what shouldn’t turn on worldly matters of fact, even if they are necessary and a priori (see the discussion of the locked room metaphor in Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations: Section 2.2.1). If correct, this is a strike against the model-theoretic definition. However, this standard logical positivist line has been recently challenged by those who see logic penetrated and permeated by metaphysics (e.g., Putnam 1971, Almog 1989, Sher 1991, Williamson 1999). We illustrate the insight behind the challenge with a simple example. Consider the following two sentences.

(4) ∃x(Female(x) & Sister(x, evan))
(5) ∃x Female(x)

(5) is a logical consequence of (4), that is, there is no domain for the quantifiers and no interpretation of the predicates and the individual constant in that domain which makes (4) true and not (5). Why? Because on any interpretation of the non-logical terminology, (4) is true just in case the intersection of the set of objects that satisfy Female(x) and the set of objects that satisfy Sister(x, evan) is non-empty. If this obtains, then the set of objects that satisfy Female(x) is non-empty and this makes (5) true. The basic metaphysical truth underlying the reasoning here is that for any two sets, if their intersection is non-empty, then neither set is the empty set. This necessary and a priori truth about the world, in particular about its set-theoretic part, is an essential reason why (5) follows from (4). This approach, reflected in the model-theoretic consequence relation (see Sher 1996), can lead to an intriguing view of the formality of logical consequence reminiscent of the pre-Wittgensteinian views of Russell and Frege. Following the above, the consequence relation from (4) to (5) is formal because the metaphysical truth on which it turns describes a formal (structural) feature of the world. In other words: it is not possible for (4) to be true and (5) false because

For any extensions of P, P’, if an object α satisfies '(P(v) & P'(v, n))', then α satisfies 'P(v)'.

According to this vision of the formality of logical consequence, the consequence relation between (4) and (5) is formal because what is in bold expresses a formal feature of reality. Russell writes that, “Logic, I should maintain, must no more admit a unicorn than zoology can; for logic is concerned with the real world just as truly as zoology, though with its more abstract and general features” (Russell 1919, p. 169). If we take the abstract and general features of the world to be its formal features, then Russell’s remark captures the view of logic that emerges from anchoring the necessity, formality and a priority of logical consequence in the formal features of the world. The question arises as to what counts as a formal feature of the world. If we say that all set-theoretic truths depict formal features of the world, including claims about how many sets there are, then this would seem to justify making

∃x∃y~(x = y)

(that is, there are at least two individuals) a logical truth since it is necessary, a priori, and a formal truth. To reflect model-theoretically that such sentences, which consist just of logical terminology, are logical truths we would require that the domain of a structure simply be the collection of the world’s individuals. See Sher (1991) for an elaboration and defense of this view of the formality of logical truth and consequence. See Shapiro (1993) for further discussion and criticism of the project of grounding our logical knowledge on primitive intuitions of logical possibility instead of on our knowledge of metaphysical truths.

Part of the difficulty in reaching a consensus with respect to whether or not the model-theoretic consequence relation reflects the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence is that philosophers and logicians differ over what the features of the common concept are. Some offer accounts of the logical consequence relation according to which it is not a priori (e.g., see Koslow 1999, Sher 1991 and see Hanson 1997 for criticism of Sher) or deny that it even need be strongly necessary (Smiley 1995, 2000, section 6). Here we illustrate with a quick example.

Given that we know that a McKeon only admires those who are older (that is, we know that (a) ∀x∀y(Admires(x, y) → OlderThan(y, x))), wouldn’t we take (7) to be a logical consequences of (6)?

(6) Admires(paige, kelly)
(7) OlderThan(kelly, paige)

A Tarskian response is that (7) is not a consequence of (6) alone, but of (6) plus (a). So in thinking that (7) follows from (6), one assumes (a). A counter suggestion is to say that (7) is a logical consequence of (6) for if (6) is true, then necessarily-relative-to-the-truth-of-(a) (7) is true. The modal notion here is a weakened sense of necessity: necessity relative to the truth of a collection of sentences, which in this case is composed of (a). Since (a) is not a priori, neither is the consequence relation between (6) and (7). The motive here seems to be that this conception of modality is inherent in the notion of logical consequence that drives deductive inference in science, law, and other fields outside of the logic classroom. This supposes that a theory of logical consequence must not only account for the features of the intuitive concept of logical consequence but also reflect the intuitively correct deductive inferences. After all, the logical consequence relation is the foundation of deductive inference: it is not correct to deductively infer B from A unless B is a logical consequence of A. Referring to our example, in a conversation where (a) is a truth that is understood and accepted by the conversants, the inference from (6) to (7) seems legit. Hence, this should be supported by an accompanying concept of logical consequence. This idea of construing the common concept of logical consequence in part by the lights of basic intuitions about correct inferences is reflected in the Relevance logician’s objection to the Tarskian account. The Relevance logician claims that X is not a logical consequence of K unless K is relevant to X. For example, consider the following pairs of sentences.

(1) (Female(evan) & ~Female(evan)) (1) Admires(kelly, paige)
(2) Admires(kelly, shannon) (2) (Female(evan) v ~Female(evan))

In the first pair, (1) is logically false, and in the second, (2) is a logical truth. Hence it isn’t possible for (1) to be true and (2) false. Since this seems to be formally determined and a priori, for each pair (2) is a logical consequence of (1) according to Tarski. Against this Anderson and Belnap write, “the fancy that relevance is irrelevant to validity [that is logical consequence] strikes us as ludicrous, and we therefore make an attempt to explicate the notion of relevance of A to B” (Anderson and Belnap 1975, pp. 17-18). The typical support for the relevance conception of logical consequence draws on intuitions regarding correct inference, e.g. it is counterintuitive to think that it is correct to infer (2) from (1) in either pair for what does being a female have to do with who one admires? Would you think it correct to infer, say, that Admires(kelly, shannon) on the basis of (Female(evan) & ~Female(evan))? For further discussion of the different types of relevance logic and more on the relevant philosophical issues see Haack (1978, pp. 198-203) and Read (1995, pp. 54-63). The bibliography in Haack (1996, pp. 264-265) is helpful. For further discussion on relevance logic, see Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions: Section 5.2.1.

Our question is, does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the essential features of the common concept of logical consequence? Our discussion illustrates at least two things. First, it isn’t obvious that the model-theoretic definition of logical consequence reflects the Tarskian portrayal of the common concept. One option, not discussed above, is to deny that the model-theoretic definition is a theoretical definition and argue for its utility simply on the basis that it is extensionally equivalent with the common concept (see Shapiro 1998). Our discussion also illustrates that Tarski’s identification of the essential features of logical consequence is disputed. One reaction, not discussed above, is to question the presupposition of the debate and take a more pluralist approach to the common concept of logical consequence. On this line, it is not so much that the common concept of logical consequence is vague as it is ambiguous. At minimum, to say that a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences is to say that X is true in every circumstance (that is logically possible situation) in which the sentences in K are true. “Different disambiguations of this notion arise from taking different extensions of the term ‘circumstance’ ” (Restall 2002, p. 427). If we disambiguate the relevant notion of ‘circumstance’ by the lights of Tarski, ‘Admires(kelly, paige)’ is a logical consequence of ‘(Female(evan) & ~Female(evan))’. If we follow the Relevance logician, then not. There is no fact of the matter about whether or not the first sentence is a logical consequence of the second independent of such a disambiguation.

c. What is a logical constant?

We turn to the second, related issue of what qualifies as a logical constant. Tarski (1936, 418-419) writes,

No objective grounds are known to me which permit us to draw a sharp boundary between [logical and non-logical terms]. It seems possible to include among logical terms some which are usually regarded by logicians as extra-logical without running into consequences which stand in sharp contrast to ordinary usage.

And at the end of his (1936), he tells us that the fluctuation in the common usage of the concept of consequence would be accurately reflected in a relative concept of logical consequence, that is a relative concept “which must, on each occasion, be related to a definite, although in greater or less degree arbitrary, division of terms into logical and extra logical” (p. 420). Unlike the relativity described in the previous paragraph, which speaks to the features of the concept of logical consequence, the relativity contemplated by Tarski concerns the selection of logical constants. Tarski’s observations of the common concept do not yield a sharp boundary between logical and non-logical terms. It seems that the sentential connectives and the quantifiers of our language M about the McKeons qualify as logical if any terms of M do. We’ve also followed many logicians and included the identity predicate as logical. (See Quine 1986 for considerations against treating ‘=’ as a logical constant.) But why not include other predicates such as ‘OlderThan’?

(1) OlderThan(kelly, paige) (3) ~OlderThan(kelly, kelly)
(2) ~OlderThan(paige, kelly)

Then the consequence relation from (1) to (2) is necessary, formal, and a priori and the truth of (3) is necessary, formal and also a priori. If treating ‘OlderThan’ as a logical constant does not do violence to our intuitions about the features of the common concept of logical consequence and truth, then it is hard to see why we should forbid such a treatment. By the lights of the relative concept of logical consequence, there is no fact of the matter about whether (2) is a logical consequence of (1) since it is relative to the selection of ‘OlderThan’ as a logical constant. On the other hand, Tarski hints that even by the lights of the relative concept there is something wrong in thinking that B follows from A and B only relative to taking ‘and’ as a logical constant. Rather, B follows from A and B we might say absolutely since ‘and’ should be on everybody’s list of logical constants. But why do ‘and’ and the other sentential connectives, along with the identity predicate and the quantifiers have more of a claim to logical constancy than, say, ‘OlderThan’? Tarski (1936) offers no criteria of logical constancy that help answer this question.

On the contemporary scene, there are three general approaches to the issue of what qualifies as a logical constant. One approach is to argue for an inherent property (or properties) of logical constancy that some expressions have and others lack. For example, topic neutrality is one feature traditionally thought to essentially characterize logical constants. The sentential connectives, the identity predicate, and the quantifiers seem topic neutral: they seem applicable to discourse on any topic. The predicates other than identity such as ‘OlderThan’ do not appear to be topic neutral, at least as standardly interpreted, e.g., ‘OlderThan’ has no application in the domain of natural numbers. One way of making the concept of topic neutrality precise is to follow Tarski’s suggestion in his (1986) that the logical notions expressed in a language L are those notions that are invariant under all one-one transformations of the domain of discourse onto itself. A one-one transformation of the domain of discourse onto itself is a one-one function whose domain and range coincide with the domain of discourse. And a one-one function is a function that always assigns different values to different objects in its domain (that is, for all x and y in the domain of f, if f(x) = f(y), then x = y).

Consider ‘Olderthan’. By Tarski’s lights, the notion expressed by the predicate is its extension, that is the set of ordered pairs <d, d’> such that d is older than d’. Recall that the extension is:

{<Beth, Matt>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>, <Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Shannon, Kelly>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Shannon, Evan>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>}.

If ‘OlderThan’ is a logical constant its extension (the notion it expresses) should be invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of discourse (that is the set of McKeons) onto itself. A set is invariant under a one-one transformation f when the set is carried onto itself by the transformation. For example, the extension of ‘Female’ is invariant under f when for every d, d is a female if and only if f(d) is. ‘OlderThan’ is invariant under f when <d, d’> is in the extension of ‘OlderThan’ if and only if <f(d), f(d’)> is. Clearly, the extensions of the Female predicate and the Olderthan relation are not invariant under every one-one transformation. For example, Beth is older than Matt, but f(Beth) is not older than f(Matt) when f(Beth) = Evan and f(Matt) = Paige. Compare the identity relation: it is invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of McKeons because it holds for each and every McKeon. The invariance condition makes precise the concept of topic neutrality. Any expression whose extension is altered by a one-one transformation must discriminate among elements of the domain, making the relevant notions topic-specific. The invariance condition can be extended in a straightforward way to the quantifiers and sentential connectives (see McCarthy 1981 and McGee 1997). Here I illustrate with the existential quantifier. Let Ψ be a well-formed formula with ‘x’ as its only free variable. '∃x Ψ' has a truth-value in the intended structure UM for our language M about the McKeons. Let f be an arbitrary one-one transformation of the domain D of McKeons onto itself. The function f determines an interpretation I’ for Ψ in the range D’ of f. The existential quantifier satisfies the invariance requirement for UM ⊨∃x Ψ if and only if U ⊨∃x Ψ for every U derived by a one-one transformation f of the domain D of UM (we say that the U‘s are isomorphic with UM ).

For example, consider the following existential quantification.

∃x Female(x)

This is true in the intended structure for our language M about the McKeons (that is, UM ⊨∃x Female(x)[g]) ultimately because the set of elements that satisfy ‘Female(x)’ on some variable assignment that extends g is non-empty (recall that Beth, Shannon, Kelly, and Paige are females). The cardinality of the set of McKeons that satisfy an M-formula is invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of McKeons onto itself. Hence, for every U isomorphic with UM, the set of elements from DU that satisfy ‘Female(x)’ on some variable assignment that extends g is non-empty and so

U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g].

Speaking to the other part of the invariance requirement given at the end of the previous paragraph, clearly for every U isomorphic with UM, if U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g], then UM ⊨∃x Female(x)[g] (since U is isomorphic with itself). Crudely, the topic neutrality of the existential quantifier is confirmed by the fact that it is invariant under all one-one transformations of the domain of discourse onto itself.

Key here is that the cardinality of the subset of the domain D that satisfies an L-formula under an interpretation is invariant under every one-one transformation of D onto itself. For example, if at least two elements from D satisfy a formula on an interpretation of it, then at least two elements from D’ satisfy the formula under the I’ induced by f. This makes not only ‘All’ and ‘Some’ topic neutral, but also any cardinality quantifier such as ‘Most’, ‘Finitely many’, ‘Few’, ‘At least two’, etc. The view suggested in Tarski (1986, p. 149) is that the logic of a language L is the science of all notions expressible in L which are invariant under one-one transformations of L’s domain of discourse. For further discussion, defense of, and extensions of the Tarskian invariance requirement on logical constancy, in addition to McCarthy (1981) and McGee (1997), see Sher (1989, 1991).

A second approach to what qualifies as a logical constant is not to make topic neutrality a necessary condition for logical constancy. This undercuts at least some of the significance of the invariance requirement. Instead of thinking that there is an inherent property of logical constancy, we allow the choice of logical constants to depend, at least in part, on the needs at hand, as long as the resulting consequence relation reflects the essential features of the intuitive, pre-theoretic concept of logical consequence. I take this view to be very close to the one that we are left with by default in Tarski (1936). The approach is suggested in Prior (1976) and developed in related but different ways in Hanson (1996) and Warmbrod (1999). It amounts to regarding logic in a strict sense and loose sense. Logic in the strict sense is the science of what follows from what relative to topic neutral expressions, and logic in the loose sense is the study of what follows from what relative to both topic neutral expressions and those topic centered expressions of interest that yield a consequence relation possessing the salient features of the common concept.

Finally, a third approach the issue of what makes an expression a logical constant is simply to reject the view of logical consequence as a formal consequence relation, thereby nullifying the need to distinguish logical terminology in the first place (see Etchemendy 1983 and Bencivenga 1999). We just say, for example, that X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences if the supposition that all of the K are true and X false violates the meaning of component terminology. Hence, ‘Female(kelly)’ is a logical consequence of ‘Sister(kelly, paige)’ simply because the supposition otherwise violates the meaning of the predicates. Whether or not ‘Female’ and ‘Sister’ are logical terms doesn’t come into play.

6. Conclusion

Using the first-order language M as the context for our inquiry, we have discussed the model-theoretic conception of the conditions that must be met in order for a sentence to be a logical consequence of others. This theoretical characterization is motivated by a distinct development of the common concept of logical consequence. The issue of the nature of logical consequence, which intersects with other areas of philosophy, is still a matter of debate. Any full coverage of the topic would involve study of the logical consequence relation between sentences from other types of languages such as modal languages (containing necessity and possibility operators) (see Hughes and Cresswell 1996) and second-order languages (containing variables that range over properties) (see Shapiro 1991). See also the entries, Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations, and Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions, in the encyclopedia.

7. References and Further Reading

  • Almog, J. (1989): “Logic and the World”, pp. 43-65 in Themes From Kaplan, ed. J. Almog, J. Perry, and H. Wettstein. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Anderson, A.R., and N. Belnap (1975): Entailment: The Logic of Relevance and Necessity. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
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Author Information

Matthew McKeon
Email: mckeonm@msu.edu
Michigan State University
U. S. A.

James Beattie (1735—1803)

beattieJames Beattie was a Scottish philosopher and poet who spent his entire academic career as Professor of Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College in Aberdeen. His best known philosophical work, An Essay on The Nature and Immutability of Truth In Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism (1770), is a rhetorical tour de force which affirmed the sovereignty of common sense while attacking David Hume (1711-1776). A smash bestseller in its day, this Essay on Truth made Beattie very famous and Hume very angry. The work’s fame proved fleeting, as did Beattie’s philosophical reputation.

While the Essay on Truth is little read today, it is well worth reading. First, it is an important document in the history of the Scottish common sense school of philosophy inaugurated by Beattie’s colleague, Thomas Reid (1710-1796). Second, Beattie’s style– lively, polished, pure, and lucid–still has the power to please and charm. Finally, Beattie is an abler philosopher than his vociferous detractors were willing to allow. Though by no means an original or profound thinker, he can and should be given credit for presenting a systematic and accessible defense of a simple-sounding thesis – that philosophy cannot afford to despise the plain dictates of common sense.

This article (1) outlines Beattie’s life and career, (2) reviews the basic argument of the Essay on Truth, (3) summarizes the Essay‘s neglected critique of Hume’s racism, (4) briefly describes Beattie’s later Elements of Moral Science, and (5) reflects on Beattie’s place in the Scottish common sense school.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Career
  2. The Essay on Truth (1770)
  3. Beattie Contra Hume on Racism
  4. Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793)
  5. Beattie and Scottish Common Sense Philosophy
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Career

James Beattie was born October 25, 1735 in Laurencekirk, Kincardineshire, where his father was a farmer and shopkeeper. In 1749 Beattie began his studies at Marischal College, Aberdeen. In 1753, he was awarded the MA degree. He then spent several years as a schoolteacher and briefly contemplated becoming a minister. During this period he also secured the friendship of several influential personages. One of Beattie’s early patrons was James Burnett (1714-1799), better known to posterity as Lord Monboddo (which name Burnett assumed when appointed to the Court of Session in 1767).

In 1760, at the tender age of 25, Beattie was installed as Professor of Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College. Shortly thereafter he was elected to the Aberdeen Philosophical Society, known to waggish locals as “the Wise Club.” Founded in 1758 by Thomas Reid (1710-1796) and John Gregory (1724-1773), the Society continued to hold meetings until 1773, nine years after Reid left for Glasgow to fill the Chair of Moral Philosophy vacated by Adam Smith (1723-1790). Much of Beattie’s later work had its origin in compositions read to his fellow Aberdonian “wise men” in the 1760s.

A decade after taking up his Professorship at Aberdeen, Beattie published the philosophical work for which he was (and is still) best known: An Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth In Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism (1770) (hereinafter “Essay on Truth”). The honors piled up thick and fast: a doctorate of laws from Oxford; an audience with King George III; a Crown pension of 200 pounds a year; the approbation of discerning literati such as Edmund Burke and Samuel Johnson; and the opportunity to pose for Sir Joshua Reynolds. (Incidentally, Reynold’s portrait of Beattie – “The Triumph of Truth, with the Portrait of a Gentleman”- was hung in Marischal College.) Nor was enthusiasm for Beattie’s anti-skeptical treatise confined to the British Isles. The Essay was soon translated into French, German, and Dutch and discussed on the Continent. Beattie’s fame spread to the New World as well. In 1784 he was made a member of the American Philosophical Society.

Not all citizens of the Republic of Letters, however, were impressed by the Essay on Truth. The book’s target, the amiable and good-humored Hume, was incensed. “Truth!” he fumed, “there is no truth in it; it is a horrible large lie in Octavo.” Yet Hume, who had a policy of not answering critics, never deigned to reply directly to the cavils of “that bigoted silly fellow Beattie.” Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), too, had harsh words for Beattie. In Kant’s Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics (1783), the Scottish prophet of common sense is portrayed as a superficial, obtuse dogmatist: “I should think that Hume might fairly have laid as much claim to common sense as Beattie, and in addition to a critical reason (such as the latter did not possess).” (For the record, however, it should be noted that Kant (unlike Hume) had an equally low opinion of Reid.)

Beattie wrote no philosophical work equal to the Essay in appeal or influence, although he continued to publish throughout the 1770s and 1780s. Many of these ostensibly “later” works (several of which actually date from the 1760s) are devoted to issues in aesthetics, rhetoric, and literary theory. They include An Essay on Poetry and Music (1776), On the Utility of Classical Learning (1776), An Essay on Laughter, and Ludicrous Composition (1779), and Dissertations Moral and Critical (1783). In addition, he compiled a lexicon entitled Scotticisms, arranged in Alphabetical Order (1787), in which he urged his educated compatriots to improve their English by “purifying” it of Scots expressions.

Beattie also earned plaudits as a poet, largely on the strength of The Minstrel; or, The Progress of Genius, written in Spenserian stanzas. The first part of The Minstrel appeared anonymously in 1771 (a year which also saw two editions of the Essay printed). The second part, to which the author put his name, followed in 1774. Replete with reflections upon Nature and the character of poetic genius, The Minstrel anticipates some of the central preoccupations of the Romantic movement.

Despite his apparent “aesthetic turn” in the post-Essay period, Beattie remained interested in the broader philosophical, moral, and religious questions that had originally prompted him to compose the Essay on Truth in the 1760s. 1786 saw the publication of Evidences of the Christian Religion Briefly and Plainly Stated, a two volume work of popular apologetics. This was followed by his final book, Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793). A lengthy collection of lectures delivered at Marischal College, the Elements deal with a wide range of topics in the philosophy of mind, epistemology, metaphysics, logic, ethics, political philosophy, economics, and natural theology.

Beattie’s later years were filled with affliction. His wife, Mary Beattie (née Dunn), went mad and was eventually committed to an asylum. Both of his children died, the elder son in 1790 and the younger in 1796. Weakened by grief, ill health, and a series of strokes, Beattie died in Aberdeen on August 18, 1803.

2. The Essay on Truth (1770)

The Essay on Truth begins predictably enough, with a definition of – what else?- truth. Truth, Beattie avows, is identified with what “the constitution of our nature determines us to believe”; falsehood is identified with what “the constitution of our nature determines us to disbelieve.” (Part I. i). The distinction between common sense and reason is drawn in terms of the way that distinct classes of truths are apprehended. Common sense is identified as “that faculty by which we perceive self-evident truth,” whereas reason is “that power by which we perceive truth in consequence of a proof.” (I. i). With these definitions securely in place, Beattie advances the Essay‘s principal thesis — “common sense is the ultimate judge of truth,” (I. i) and reason must be subordinated to it. All sound reasoning, we are told, depends upon the principles of common sense:

In a word, the dictates of common sense are, in respect to human knowledge in general, what the axioms of geometry are in respect to mathematics: on the supposition that those axioms are false or dubious, all mathematical reasoning falls to the ground; and on the supposition that the dictates of common sense are erroneous and deceitful, all science, truth, and virtue, are vain. (I. ii. 9)

What are these axioms of common sense, these foundational principles on which all sound reasoning rests? It is not necessary to discuss all the principles listed in Beattie’s catalogue of common sense. For the purpose of illustration, a representative sample of four “principles of common sense” should suffice: (i) the evidence of perception (or “external sense”) is not fallacious, but fundamentally reliable; (ii) whatever begins to exist, proceeds from some cause; (iii) Nature is uniform; and (iv) human testimony is basically trustworthy. Armed with this arsenal of principles, Beattie can now confidently enter the lists against an assortment of formidable philosophical foes. Beattie wielded principle (i) against skeptics (be they Cartesian or Humean), as well as against Berkeleyan idealists; principle (ii) against atheist critics of cosmological arguments; principle (iii) against Humean skeptics about induction; and principle (iv) against Humean scoffers at miracles.

If Beattie is right about common sense, much (if not all) of modern philosophy is wrong. The basic mistake of the moderns lies in their tendency to make reason, not common-sense, the ultimate judge or arbiter of truth. Reason is a shameless upstart who, ignorant of its proper station, disgraces itself by refusing to submit to authority (in the form of common sense). Such insubordination can only lead to chaos, catastrophe, and confusion:

When Reason invades the rights of Common Sense, and presumes to arraign that authority by which she herself acts, nonsense and confusion must of necessity ensue; science will soon come to have neither head nor tail, beginning nor end; philosophy will grow contemptible; and its adherents, far from being treated, as in former times, upon the footing of conjurers, will be thought by the vulgar, and by every man of sense, to be little better than downright fools. (I. ii. 9)

Philosophers therefore despise common sense at their peril. But how are we to distinguish genuine principles of common sense from the pretenders? Is Beattie suggesting that any cherished conviction or idée fixe that I am unable to prove automatically qualifies as a dictate of common sense? He endeavours to supply us with criteria or marks by which authentic principles of common sense can be identified. (1) We are irresistibly inclined by nature to believe the principles of common sense. Our powerful attachment to them, being spontaneous and quasi-instinctive, cannot be destroyed by philosophical argument – no matter how ingenious. (2) The principles of common sense are universally accepted. Far from being prejudices peculiar to a given time, place, culture, sect, or class, they have been believed by virtually all people in all ages. (3) The principles of common sense cannot be proven because they are epistemologically foundational or basic. They cannot be justified by reference to some more evident proposition(s), because none exist. (4) The principles of common sense are indispensable presuppositions of our conduct and practice. We cannot live or act prudently unless we assume that our senses are reliable, that human testimony can be a source of knowledge, that past will resemble the future, and so on. Anyone who actually doubted or denied such principles would put himself on par with the lunatic or the fool.

Here it may be asked: In what way does Beattie’s Essay on Truth improve upon Thomas Reid’s earlier Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense (1764)? The short answer is that it does not. Beattie freely admits that he is heavily indebted to Reid. However, the Essay differs from the Inquiry in one obvious respect: Beattie’s tract is infinitely more hard-hitting and caustic than anything ever penned by Reid. Where Reid writes respectfully of his opponents, Beattie tends to denounce and vilify them. Where Reid wraps up his subtle thoughts in restrained professorial prose, Beattie’s simple arguments are presented with the spleen and verve of the born orator. These contrasts reflect a more basic difference between our two defenders of common sense. Unlike Reid, Beattie is first and foremost a moralist and an apologist. He is not interested in defending a subtle or nuanced philosophical thesis. Rather, Beattie is defending a lofty (albeit vaguely defined) cause – to wit, “the cause of truth, virtue, and mankind.” Translated into more prosaic (but precise) terms, Beattie’s “cause” is that of deflecting philosophical opposition to a broadly Judeo-Christian understanding of human nature. According to this understanding, human beings are free but finite creatures made in the image of a good God or Creator. Neither brutes nor divinities, we occupy an intermediate place in creation and are better suited for action than for speculation. Inasmuch as our cognitive faculties are God-given, we may trust their deliverances – provided we acknowledge their limitations and exercise them under conditions that define our humble “middle state” (to quote Alexander Pope). Beattie’s bold strategy in the Essay was to argue that these familiar ideas about human nature are unassailable because they rest on the solid and irrefragable foundation of “common sense” (rather than philosophic demonstrability). Here was a book apt to reassure the devout but timorous Christian reader, for it confidently announced that Humean scepticism – and the bulk of modern philosophy – was infinitely more suited to be ridiculed than to be feared.

3. Beattie Contra Hume on Racism

Although the Essay on Truth is largely devoted to re-instating the rights of common sense in the spheres of epistemology and metaphysics, it includes a forceful critique of Hume’s racism.

Hume’s racism? To some, this phrase may have a strange and novel sound. After all, Hume is usually portrayed as a patron saint of the Enlightenment: a genial cosmopolitan, sweetly reasonable, unfailingly courteous and amiable, “as approaching as nearly to the idea of a perfectly wise and virtuous man, as perhaps the nature of human frailty will permit” (in the oft-cited words of his friend, Adam Smith). Yet in Hume’s essay “Of National Characters,” we catch a glimpse of a different side of le bon David. For there, in an infamous footnote, Hume writes:

I am apt to suspect the negroes to be naturally inferior to the whites. There scarcely ever was a civilized nation of that complexion, nor any individual, eminent either in action or speculation. No ingenious manufactures amongst them, no arts, no sciences … [T]here are Negroe slaves dispersed all over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms of ingenuity.

In the Essay on Truth, Beattie condemns these sentiments: “These assertions are strong; but I know not whether they have anything else to recommend them.” (III. ii). Beattie does not stop there. Beattie does not merely fulminate against Hume’s racism with a self-serving show of conspicuous indignation; instead he rolls up his sleeves and adroitly dissects Hume’s pro-racist arguments. (1) Beattie disputes Hume’s basic assertions about the achievements (or alleged lack thereof) of non-European societies: “[W]e know that these assertions are not true … The Africans and Americans are known to have many ingenious manufactures and arts among them, which even Europeans would find it no easy matter to imitate.” (III. ii). (2) Moreover, Beattie says, Hume’s reasoning is invalid. For even if Hume’s claims were correct, his conclusion would not follow. “[O]ne may as well say of an infant, that he can never become a man, as of a nation now barbarous, that it never can be civilized.” (III. Ii). Should anyone doubt this, he need only recall that “[t]hat the inhabitants of Great Britain and France were as savage two thousand years ago, as those of Africa and America are at this day.” (III. ii). (3) Beattie is unimpressed by Hume’s argument that “there are Negroe slaves dispersed all over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms of ingenuity.” Beattie insists that this claim is unwarranted as well as false. But even if it were true, it would not justify belief in Hume’s natural inferiority thesis, for “the condition of a slave is not favourable to genius of any kind.” (III. ii). (4) While Beattie does not downgrade European achievements in the arts and sciences, he denies that they can be used to prove that European nations or “races” are superior. He stresses the extent that the achievements on which European nations pride themselves were either discovered by accident or the inventions of a gifted few, to whom alone all credit must go.

Beattie caps his rebuttal with two observations. First, his critique of Hume’s natural inferiority thesis indirectly supports the cause of religion because such racism cannot be reconciled neatly with a true Judeo-Christian understanding of human nature. Second, Beattie stresses that his disagreement with Hume on the subject of racism is not merely theoretical or speculative. On the contrary, the dispute is intensely practical, for the natural inferiority thesis can (and frequently was) invoked to justify slavery – an institution that Beattie, a committed abolitionist, decried as “a barbarous piece of policy.”

4. Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793)

There is considerable overlap between the Essay on Truth and Beattie’s later Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793). The creed of common sense is again soberly recited. We are told that consciousness, memory, and testimony must be taken as trustworthy, that we can assume that Nature is uniform, that we are free moral agents, and that whatever begins to exist must proceed from some cause.

Despite these and other doctrinal similarities, the Elements differs from the Essay in at least four respects. First, stylistically the Essay was full of sarcasm, scorn and splendid invective, while the Elements is comparatively tame, subdued, and dry. Second, the Elements is more philosophically constructive than the Essay, as Beattie now appears more interested in building and inhabiting his own modest system than in laying siege to the systems of foes and rivals. Third, the Elements offers a more in-depth exploration of several topics only lightly touched upon in the Essay (for example, perception, natural theology, and immortality). Finally, the Elements offers sustained coverage of several areas, such as political philosophy and economics, that are not meaningfully discussed in the Essay.

5. Beattie and Scottish Common Sense Philosophy

Historians of Scottish philosophy frequently describe Beattie’s Essay as a simplified version of the philosophy of common sense expounded by Reid in his Inquiry of 1764. While there is much truth in this judgment, it need not be construed as a reproach. Popularization can be done well or badly. Beattie did it well.

Nevertheless, it is undeniable that Reid’s views on matters philosophical evolved in a way that Beattie’s never did. After retiring from teaching in 1781, Reid published two major works, Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man (1785) and Essays on the Active Powers of Man (1788). More sophisticated and constructive than anything Beattie ever produced, these two books, along with Reid’s earlier Inquiry, became the founding documents of the Scottish common sense school of philosophy. The Reidian gospel was soon propagated with aplomb by Edinburgh Chair-holder Dugald Stewart (1753-1828), who had listened to Reid’s lectures in Glasgow. An elegant stylist, Stewart championed common sense both in his well-attended lectures and in his edifying books, the first pair of which – Elements of the Philosophy of the Human Mind (1792) and Outlines of Moral Philosophy (1793) – appeared around the same time as Beattie’s Elements of Moral Science. Stewart’s interest in Reid was shared by another renowned Edinburgh professor, the erudite but preternaturally verbose Sir William Hamilton (1788-1856). No slavish disciple, Hamilton sought to “improve” on Reid’s philosophy in various ways, often by drawing on Kantian doctrines. A singular philosophical beast, the resulting hybrid was slain, stuffed, and mounted by John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) in An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy (1865). Nevertheless, Hamilton’s extensively (or, as some might say, obsessively) annotated edition of Reid’s Collected Works did much to make them more widely available.

With Reid cast thus as the heroic founder of the emerging Scotch school, Beattie was relegated to the supporting role of ardent and skilful propagandist. This, at any rate, was how Dugald Stewart portrays Beattie in a letter to Sir William Forbes, Beattie’s friend and biographer. Stewart declares that the Essay on Truth is effective as “a popular antidote against the illusions of metaphysical scepticism,” but, he is quick to add, Beattie’s polemic lacks the subtlety, patience, and precision we find in Reid. Nevertheless, Stewart avers that Beattie’s achievement is not negligible:

These critical remarks on the “Essay on Truth” (I must request you to observe) do not in the least affect the essential merits of that very valuable performance; and I have stated them with the greater freedom, because your late excellent friend possessed so many other unquestionable claims to high distinction – as a moralist, as a critic, as a grammarian, as a pure and classical writer, and, above all, as the author of the “Minstrel.” In any one of the different paths to which his ambition has led him, it would not perhaps be difficult to name some of his contemporaries by whom he has been surpassed; but where is the individual to be found, who has aspired with greater success to an equal variety of literary honours?

Stewart’s verdict still seems a just one. Beattie was a talented, ambitious, and multi-faceted man of letters, but his gifts and merits as a philosopher were not the greatest. If philosophy is indeed “a series of footnotes to Plato” (Whitehead), then Beattie can be read as a dramatic footnote to Reid and – ironically – to the abhorred Hume.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Cloyd, E. L. (1972) James Burnett, Lord Monboddo. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
    • Touches on Monboddo’s relationship with Beattie; indicates why their friendship did not last.
  • Fieser, J. (1994) “Beattie’s Lost Letter to the London Review,” Hume Studies 20: 1-12.
    • Reconstructs a controversy between Beattie and a pro-Humean literary faction.
  • Fieser, J. (2000) “Introduction” to James Beattie’s Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth in Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism. Volume 2 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. (ed. J. Fieser) Bristol, UK: Thoemmes Press.
    • Thorough presentation of Beattie’s defence of common sense in the Essay on Truth.
  • Fieser, J. (ed.) (2000) Early Responses to Reid, Oswald, Beattie, and Stewart: I. Volume 3 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. Bristol, UK: Thoemmes Press.
    • Contains early reviews of the Essay (including Edmund Burke’s positive notice of the second edition of 1771).
  • Grave, S.A. (1960) The Scottish Philosophy of Common Sense. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
    • Beattie’s epistemological and metaphysical views are portrayed as vulgarized versions of Reid’s.
  • Harris, J. A. (2002) “James Beattie, The Doctrine of Liberty, and the Science of the Mind,” Reid Studies (5): 16-29.
    • Acknowledges Beattie’s shortcomings as a philosopher, but credits him with a commitment to understanding the human mind scientifically. Sheds light on the Essay’s critique of necessitarianism.
  • King, E.H. (1971) “A Scottish “Philosophical” Club in the Eighteenth Century,” Dalhousie Review (50): 201-214.
    • Describes the inner workings of the Aberdeen Philosophical Society, and discusses Beattie’s participation.
  • King, E.H. (1972) “James Beattie’s Essay on Truth (1770): An Enlightenment “Bestseller”,” Dalhousie Review (51): 390-403.
    • An account of the Essay‘s popularity.
  • Kuehn, M. (1987) Scottish Common Sense in Germany, 1768-1800: A Contribution to the History of the Critical Philosophy. Kingston and Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press.
    • Discusses the influence of Reid and, to a lesser extent, Beattie and Oswald upon Kant and his German contemporaries. A clear-headed, fair assessment of Beattie’s strengths and weaknesses.
  • McCosh, J. (1875) The Scottish Philosophy. London: Macmillan.
    • Chapter XXIX contains a biographical sketch and an outline of the Essay. Depicts Beattie as an eloquent popularizer of the philosophy of common sense.
  • Mossner, E.C. (1980) The Life of David Hume. 2nd edition. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
    • Briefly describes the reaction of Hume and his Edinburgh circle to the Essay‘s success.
  • Popkin, R.H. (1980) The High Road to Pyrrhonism. San Diego: Austin Hill Press.
    • Contains an article entitled “Hume’s Racism” (pp. 251-266), in which Popkin helpfully puts Beattie’s critique of Hume’s racism in historical context.
  • Priestley, J. (1774) An Examination of Dr. Reid’s Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense, Dr. Beattie’s Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth, and Dr. Oswald’s Appeal to Common Sense in Behalf of Religion. London: J. Johnson.
    • Includes an extended critique of Beattie, composed shortly after the Essay’s publication. Priestley complains that the Essay‘s author is (among other things) an incorrigible dogmatist who relies too heavily on ad hominem arguments. The Appendix includes some correspondence between Beattie and Priestley.

Author Information

Douglas McDermid
Email: dmcdermi@trentu.ca
Trent University
Canada

Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism is a position in the philosophy of mind according to which mental states or events are caused by physical states or events in the brain but do not themselves cause anything. It seems as if our mental life affects our body, and, via our body, the physical world surrounding us: it seems that sharp pains make us wince, it seems that fear makes our heart beat faster, it seems that remembering an embarrassing situation makes us blush and it seems that the perception of an old friend makes us smile. In reality, however, these sequences are the result of causal processes at an underlying physical level: what makes us wince is not the pain, but the neurophysiological process which causes the pain; what makes our heart beat faster is not fear, but the state of our nervous system which causes the fear etc. According to a famous analogy of Thomas Henry Huxley, the relationship between mind and brain is like the relationship between the steam-whistle which accompanies the work of a locomotive engine and the engine itself: just as the steam-whistle is caused by the engine’s operations but has no causal influence upon it, so too the mental is caused by the workings of neurophysiological mechanisms but has no causal influence upon their operation.

Table of Contents

  1. What Is Epiphenomenalism?
  2. Epiphenomenalism in the 18th and 19th Century
  3. Epiphenomenalism in the 20th Century
  4. Arguments for Epiphenomenalism
    1. The No-Gap-Argument
    2. Arguments from the Debate about Mental Causation
      1. The Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental
      2. The Argument from Anti-Individualism
      3. The Argument from Causal Exclusion
    3. Libet’s Experiments
  5. Arguments against Epiphenomenalism
    1. The Argument from Counterintuitiveness
    2. The Argument from Introspection
    3. The Argument from Evolution
    4. The Argument from the Impossibility of Knowledge of Other Minds
    5. The Argument from Davidson’s Reasons for / Reasons for which Distinction
    6. Other Arguments
  6. References and Further Reading

1. What Is Epiphenomenalism?

In the beginning epiphenomenalism was known as the doctrine of “automatism” or as the “conscious automaton theory.” The term “epiphenomenalism” seems to have been introduced in 1890 in William James’s The Principles of Psychology (it occurs once in the chapter entitled “The Automaton-Theory;” other than that James uses the terms “automaton-theory” or “conscious automaton-theory;” see Robinson 2003). The term “epiphenomenon” was used in medicine in the late nineteenth century as a label for a symptom concurrent with, but not causally contributory to, a disease (an epiphenomenon is thus something like a secondary symptom, a mere afterglow of real phenomena). Accordingly, epiphenomenalism in the philosophy of mind holds that our actions have purely physical causes (neurophysiological changes in the brain, say), while our intention, desire or volition to act does not cause our actions but is itself caused by the physical causes of our actions. To assume that regular successions of mental and physical events—volitions followed by appropriate behavior, fear followed by an increased heart rate, pains followed by wincings etc.—reflect causal processes is to commit the fallacy of post hoc, propter hoc: “The soul stands related to the body as the bell of a clock to the works, and consciousness answers to the sound which the bell gives out when it is struck” (Huxley 1874, 242).

2. Epiphenomenalism in the 18th and 19th Century

One of the first explicit formulations of epiphenomenalism can be found in the Essai de Psychologie of the Swiss naturalist and philosophical writer Charles Bonnet, dating from 1755: “the soul is a mere spectator of the movements of its body; […] the latter performs of itself all that series of actions which constitutes life; […] it moves of itself; […] it is the body alone which reproduces ideas, compares and arranges them; which forms reasonings, imagines and executes plans of all kinds, etc.” (Bonnet 1755, 91). More than a century later, the British philosopher Shadworth Hodgson also expressed the view that “[s]tates of consciousness are not produced by previous states of consciousness, but both are produced by the action of the brain; and, conversely, there is no ground for saying that […] states of consciousness react upon the brain or modify its action” (Hodgson 1865, part 1, ch. 5, §30). The most prominent articulation and defense of epiphenomenalism, however, stems from the Presidential Address to the British Association for the Advancement of Science of the British biologist, physiologist and philosopher Thomas Henry Huxley, published in 1874 with the suggestive title “On the hypothesis that animals are automata, and its history.” Huxley argued that brute animals and (presumably) human beings are conscious automata: they enjoy a conscious mental life, but their behavior is determined solely by physical mechanisms. Huxley was convinced that the body of humans and animals is a purely physical mechanism and that the physical processes of life are explainable in the same way as all other physical phenomena. This mechanistic conception, he held, “has not only successfully repelled every assault that has been made upon it, but […] is now the expressed or implied fundamental proposition of the whole doctrine of scientific Physiology” (Huxley 1874, 200). Already Descartes had argued that non-human animals are mere mechanical automata and subject to the same laws as other unconscious matter, and Huxley wholeheartedly embraced Descartes’s defense of automatism by appeal to reflex actions (Huxley 1874, 218). Huxley observed that a frog with certain parts of his brain extracted was unable to initiate actions but nevertheless able to carry out a range of reflex-like actions. Since he thought that the partial leucotomy made sure the frog was totally unconscious, he concluded that consciousness was not necessary for the execution of reflex actions:

The frog walks, hops, swims, and goes through his gymnastic performances quite as well without consciousness, and consequently without volition, as with it; and, if a frog, in his natural state, possesses anything corresponding with what we call volition, there is no reason to think that it is anything but a concomitant of the molecular changes in the brain which form part of the series involved in the production of motion. (Huxley 1874, 240)

Huxley agreed with Descartes that animals are automata, but he was unwilling to accept that they are devoid of mentality: “Sleeping dogs frequently appear to dream. If they do, it must be admitted that ideation goes on in them while they are asleep; and, in that case, there is no reason to doubt that they are conscious” (Huxley 1898, 125). Huxley therefore segregated the question of consciousness from the question of the status of an automaton: animals do experience pain, but that pain is, like their bodily movements, just a result of neurophysiological processes. Animals are conscious automata. In contrast to Descartes, Huxley argued that considerations similar to those about reflex actions in frogs also suggest that we are conscious automata. He referred to a case study of a certain Dr. Mesnet who had examined a French soldier who had suffered severe brain damage during the Franco-Prussian war in 1870. From time to time this soldier fell into a trance-like state in which he was able to execute a series of complex actions while apparently being unconscious:

If the man happens to be in a place to which he is accustomed, he walks about as usual; […] He eats, drinks, smokes, walks about, dresses and undresses himself, rises and goes to bed at the accustomed hours. Nevertheless, pins may be run into his body, or strong electric shocks sent through it, without causing the least indication of pain; no odorous substance, pleasant or unpleasant, makes the least impression; he eats and drinks with avidity whatever is offered, and takes asafœtida, or vinegar, or quinine, as readily as water; no noise affects him; and light influences him only under certain conditions. (Huxley 1874, 228)

Since Mesnet’s patient could carry out actions ordinarily performed with consciousness as initiating or coordinating element while apparently being unconscious, consciousness did not seem to be necessary for their execution. Since it was impossible to prove that the patient was indeed unconscious in his abnormal state, Huxley did not claim to have proven that humans are conscious automata, but he at least thought that “the case of the frog goes a long way to justify the assumption that, in the abnormal state, the man is a mere insensible machine” (Huxley 1874, 235). Huxley’s naturalistic or mechanistic attitude towards the body convinced him that the brain alone causes behavior. At the same time, his dualism convinced him that the mental is essentially non-physical. He reconciled these apparently discordant claims by degrading mentality to the status of an epiphenomenon.

3. Epiphenomenalism in the 20th Century

Most contemporary philosophers reject substance dualism and the question that plagued Descartes–How can an immaterial mind whose nature is to think and a material body whose nature is to be spatially extended causally interact?–no longer arises. Moreover, many philosophers even reject Huxley’s event-dualism in favor of psychophysical event-identities. According to one version of non-reductive physicalism, for instance, every concrete mental event (every event token) is identical to a concrete physical event, although there are no one-one correlations between mental and physical properties (event types). Since fear is identical to the neurophysiological event which causes the increased heart rate, fear causes the increased heart rate, too, and epiphenomenalism seems avoided. However, the charge of epiphenomenalism re-arises in a different guise. There is a forceful intuition that events cause what they cause in virtue of some of their properties. Suppose a soprano sings the word “freedom” at a high pitch and amplitude, causing a nearby window to shatter. The singing which causes the shattering is both the singing of a high C and the singing of the word “freedom.” Intuitively, only the former, not the latter, is causally relevant for the singing’s causing the shattering: “Meaningful sounds, if they occur at the right pitch and amplitude, can shatter glass, but the fact that the sounds have meaning is irrelevant to their effect. The glass would shatter if the sounds meant something completely different or if they meant nothing at all” (Dretske 1989, 1-2). If events cause their effects in virtue of some of their properties but not in virtue of others, the question arises whether mental events (even if they are identical to physical events) cause their effects in virtue of their mental, their physical or both kinds of properties. If mental events cause their effects only in virtue of their physical properties, then their being mental events is causally irrelevant and mental properties are, in a certain sense, epiphenomena (three reasons for thinking that mental properties are causally irrelevant are discussed in section 4b). Following Brian McLaughlin, one can thus distinguish between event– or token-epiphenomenalism on the one hand and property– or type-epiphenomenalism on the other (see McLaughlin 1989, 1994). According to the event- or token-epiphenomenalism defended by Huxley, concrete physical events are causes, but mental events cannot cause anything. According to the kind of property- or type-epiphenomenalism that threatens modern non-reductive physicalism, events are causes in virtue of their physical properties, but no event is a cause in virtue of its mental properties. If event-epiphenomenalism is wrong, mental events can be causes; but if they are causes solely in virtue of their physical properties, property-epiphenomenalism is still true, and some consider this to be no less disconcerting than Huxley’s original epiphenomenalism (see

4. Arguments for Epiphenomenalism

Arguments in favor of a philosophical theory typically focus on its advantages compared to other theories—that it can explain more phenomena or that it provides a more economical or a more unifying explanation of the relevant phenomena. There are no arguments for epiphenomenalism in that sense. Epiphenomenalism is just not an attractive or desirable theory. Rather, it is a theory of last resort into which people are pushed by the feeling that all the alternatives are even less plausible. Even epiphenomenalists admit that, from the first-person point of view of a thinking and feeling subject, they don’t like it. Why, then, do people embrace epiphenomenalism?

a. The No-Gap-Argument

Epiphenomenalism required an intellectual climate in which two apparently discordant beliefs about the world were equally well entrenched: a dualism with respect to mind and body on the one hand and a scientific naturalism or mechanism concerning the body on the other. To most thinkers of the eighteenth and nineteenth century, it seemed obvious that human beings enjoy a mental life that resists incorporation into a purely materialist ontology. Our thoughts, sensations, desires etc. just seemed to be too dissimilar from ordinary physical phenomena for them to be “nothing but” physical phenomena. At the same time, however, science saw the advent of a decidedly naturalistic attitude towards the human body, motivated by the successes of mechanistic physics in other areas and characterized by a desire to identify the underlying causal structure of every observed phenomenon in terms of matter and motion alone. In particular, neurophysiological research was unable to reveal any mental influence upon the brain or the body. Eventually, with the demise of vitalism regarding the forces governing animate life, the conception of the physical as a causally closed system, in which physical forces are the only forces, became almost universally accepted. When combined with the naturalistic assumption that human beings are a part of the physical world and governed by its laws, this left no room for any causal efficacy of our mental life. There simply seemed to be “no gaps” (McLaughlin 1994, 278) in the causal mechanisms that could be filled by non-physical phenomena. Therefore, epiphenomenalism can be regarded as the inevitable result of the attempt to combine a scientific naturalism with respect to the body with a dualism with respect to the mind. Human beings are exhaustively governed by physical laws so that no non-physical causes must be invoked to explain their behavior, but since they are also subjects of non-physical minds, these minds must be causally irrelevant. Whenever our trust in the causal authority of the physical is overwhelmed by our first-person experience of ourselves as creatures with an essentially non-physical mind, epiphenomenalism is waiting in the wings. This holds for Huxley’s version of epiphenomenalism no less than for modern property-epiphenomenalism–both are driven by the idea that some of our mental life is distinct from that part of the physical that is the ultimate and only authority with regard to causation.

b. Arguments from the Debate about Mental Causation

Those who defend epiphenomenalism typically do so because they fail to see how it could not be true. How could our mind make a causal difference to our physical body? This is the so-called “problem of mental causation.” That there is mental causation is part and parcel of our self-conception as freely deliberating agents that are the causal origins of their actions and do what they do because they have the beliefs and desires they have. Yet, the How of mental causation constitutes a serious philosophical problem. Its solution requires an account that shows exactly how the mental fits into the causal structure of an otherwise physical world in such a way as to exert a genuine causal influence, and any such account faces at least three difficulties. First, causation seems to require laws, but there are grounds for denying the existence of appropriate laws connecting the mental and the physical (the “Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental”). Second, causation is arguably a local or intrinsic affair, while in the case of beliefs and desires, for instance, those aspects constitutive of them insofar as they are mental are arguably relational or extrinsic (the “Argument from Anti-Individualism”). Third, we do not understand how the mental can be causally efficacious without coming into conflict with other parts of the causal structure we know (or at least suspect) to play an indispensable causal role in the production of physical effects (the “Argument from Causal Exclusion”).

i. The Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental

The Anomalous Monism of Donald Davidson was one of the earliest versions of non-reductive physicalism (see Davidson 1970). Davidson devised it to reconcile the idea that the mental is part of the physical causal network with the idea that we are autonomous agents in voluntary control of our actions. The problem is that the latter idea requires, while the former explicitly denies, that “[m]ental events such as perceivings, rememberings, decisions, and actions resist capture in the nomological net of physical theory” (Davidson 1970, 207). On the one hand, since cause and effect must always fall under a strict causal law, if the mental is to be causally efficacious, it must be subject to strict laws. On the other hand, we can be autonomous agents only if the mental is not part of the potentially deterministic nomological network of physics; true autonomy requires that there be no strict laws connecting mental events with other mental events or with physical events and that the concepts necessary to describe, explain and predict actions and to ascribe attitudes not be reducible by definition or natural law to the concepts employed by physical sciences (Davidson 1970, 212). The exact nature of Davidson’s argument for this “anomaly of the mental” is a matter of dispute, but his idea seems to be that the existence of strict psychophysical or psychological laws, together with the strict and potentially deterministic physical laws, would be at odds with the essentially holistic and rational nature of belief attributions (Davidson 1970, 219-221.) If causation requires causes and effects to fall under strict laws, and if there are no strict laws concerning mental events, mental causation seems to be impossible. This is the “Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental.” One response would be to abandon the requirement that causes and effects must fall under strict laws. Another response would be to retain the causal law requirement but to deny that the mental is anomalous in the relevant sense. Davidson himself did neither of these. His Anomalous Monism was designed to show that mental causation is in fact compatible with the causal law requirement and the absence of strict psychological and psychophysical laws. Davidson derived Anomalous Monism from the following three seemingly inconsistent premises: (1) Principle of Causal Interaction: At least some mental events causally interact with physical events. (2) Principle of the Nomological Character of Causality: Events related as cause and effect fall under strict causal laws. (3) Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental: There are no strict psychological or psychophysical laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained. (1) and (2) apparently imply the falsity of (3): “it is natural to reason that the first two principles […] together imply that at least some mental events can be predicted and explained on the basis of laws, while the principle of the anomalism of the mental denies this” (Davidson 1970, 209). Davidson’s goal was to interpret (1), (2), and (3) in such a way that they are not only consistent but jointly entail that particular mental events which causally interact with other events are identical to physical events. According to Davidson, (1) is an extensional claim about a relation between particular events: although the assertion of the causal relation between two events c and e requires describing them, the causal relation itself holds “no matter how they are described” (Davidson 1993, 6; 1970, 215). In contrast, (2) and (3) concern laws. Since “laws are linguistic” (Davidson 1970, 215) and thus an intensional affair, particular events fall under laws “only as described.” (2) says that whenever two events c and e are related as cause and effect, there are descriptions “dc” and “de” of c and e, respectively, under which c and e instantiate a causal law, although there may be descriptions “d*c” and “d*e” under which they do not instantiate a causal law (although “d*c caused d*e” is nevertheless a true singular causal statement). Given this, it is easy to see why Davidson thinks that (1), (2), and (3) entail that mental events which causally interact with other events must be identical to physical events. By (1), some mental event m causes or is caused by a physical event p. By (2), m and p must therefore instantiate a strict causal law. That is, there must be descriptions “dm” and “dp” of m and p, respectively, such that “dm-events cause dp-events” (or “dp-events cause dm-events”) is a strict causal law. By (3), this can only be a physical law. Hence, “dm” and “dp” must belong to the vocabulary of physics. Since events are mental or physical “only as described” and since m has with “dm” at least one physical description, m must thus be a physical event (Davidson 1970, 224). However, while causation may admittedly be an extensional relation between particular events, many philosophers have argued that which causal relations an event enters into is determined by which event-types it falls under. The singing’s being the singing of a high C, it seems, is causally relevant for its causing the shattering, while its being the singing of the word “freedom” is not. According to Anomalous Monism, Davidson’s critics claim, only the strict laws of physics can be causal laws, and hence events seem to be causally related only in virtue of falling under physical event-types, rendering mental event-types causally irrelevant:

Davidson’s argument for Anomalous Monism shows that any causal relation involving a mental event and a physical event holds only because a strict physical law subsumes the two events under physical kinds or descriptions. The fact that the mental event is a mental event, or that it is the kind of mental event that it is, appears to be entirely immaterial to the causal relation. […] Individual mental events […] do have causal efficacy, but only because they fall under physical kinds, and the mental kinds that they are have […] nothing to say about what causal relations they enter into. The causal structure of the world is wholly determined by the physical kinds and properties instantiated by events of this world. (Kim 2003b, 126)

This is a prominent objection against Anomalous Monism (see, for example, Honderich 1982; Kim 1989a, 1993a; Sosa 1993). Anomalous Monism may avoid token- or event-physicalism, but it seems to succumb to type- or property-epiphenomenalism: mental events, by being identical to physical events, are causally efficacious, but that they are the kind of mental event they are adds nothing to their causal efficacy (for responses on behalf of Anomalous Monism see Campbell 1997, 1998; Davidson 1993; Lepore & Loewer 1987; McLaughlin 1989).

ii. The Argument from Anti-Individualism

Anti-individualism or externalism holds that the content of mental states and the meaning of some natural language terms is a relational, or extrinsic, rather than a local, or intrinsic, property (see Burge 1979; Putnam 1975). What are local or relational properties? Suppose Sarah weighs 110 pounds, is four foot five, has blond hair and is taller than Jack. The first three properties seem to be local in the sense that they supervene upon Sarah’s internal make-up and Sarah can acquire or loose them only if she herself undergoes some change. The fourth property, in contrast, seems to be relational in the sense that Sarah has it only by courtesy of certain external facts, namely, only if there is someone else, Jack, who is smaller than she is. If Jack grows tall enough, Sarah loses the property of being taller than Jack, although she herself does not undergo any change. According to Hilary Putnam, meanings of natural kind terms are relational properties (see Putnam 1975). What Sarah means by an utterance of, say, “water,” “tiger,” “elm,” or “gold” is not determined solely by her internal make-up, but also by her environment. Consequently, such terms can mean different things in the mouth of molecularly identical twins that are indistinguishable with regard to their local properties. Meanings “just ain’t in the head,” as Putnam famously put it. Moreover, the contents of the corresponding thoughts seem to be relational properties, too: what Sarah believes when she has a belief she would express as, say, “Water is wet” is determined by the way the world is and not solely by how things are “inside” her. Tyler Burge went even further and argued that natural kind terms are not the only terms whose meaning is determined by external factors and that not only differences in the physical environment can affect the meaning of a term or the content of a belief, but also differences in a subject’s historical, linguistic, or social environment (see Burge 1979). Externalism or anti-individualism makes mental causation problematic. Causality seems to be an entirely local affair in the sense that a system’s behavior apparently supervenes upon its internal make-up. Consequently, two systems exactly alike in all internal respects will behave in exactly the same way, so that relational properties like being a genuine dollar coin or being a photo of Sarah do not seem to make a difference to the behavior of, say, a vending machine or a scanner: as long as the piece of metal inserted into a vending machine has a certain set of local properties, the vending machine will exhibit a certain behavior, no matter whether the piece of mental inserted is a genuine dollar coin or a counterfeit, and a scanner will produce a certain distribution of pixels on the screen, no matter whether the object scanned is a photo of Sarah or a piece of paper locally indistinguishable from a photo of Sarah. The assumption that causation is a local affair, when combined with externalism or anti-individualism, leads to epiphenomenalism: the meaning or content of a mental state, being a relational property, threatens to be as irrelevant for our behavior as the property of being a genuine dollar coin is for the behavior of a vending machine. In order to avoid epiphenomenalism, we must either eschew anti-individualism or show how relational mental properties can make a causal difference. Jerry Fodor tried to explicate a notion of “narrow content” according to which the mental states of intrinsically indistinguishable subjects must have the same contents, although their relationally individuated “wide contents” may differ (see Fodor 1987, ch. 1, 1991). Since narrow contents supervene upon the intrinsic make-up of a subject, Fodor held, the charge of epiphenomenalism can be avoided. However, he has recently given up on this idea because it proved extremely difficult to say exactly what narrow contents are (see Fodor 1995). Frank Jackson and Philip Pettit argue that relational properties can be causally relevant in virtue of figuring in so called “program explanations,” although strictly speaking the causal work is done solely by local properties (see, for example, Jackson & Pettit 1990). In a similar vein, Lynne Rudder Baker and Tyler Burge claim that the charge of epiphenomenalism “just melts away” (Baker 1993, 93) if we acknowledge that our explanatory practice which undoubtedly treats explanations in terms of relational properties as causal explanations trumps any metaphysical armchair argument to the contrary (see Baker 1993, 1995; Burge 1993). And Fred Dretske argues that while the triggering causes of behavior are always local, relational mental properties can make a causal difference in virtue of being structuring causes of behavior, that is, in virtue of structuring a causal system in such a way that the occurrence of a triggering neurophysiological cause causes a given behavioral effect (see, for example, Dretske 1988).

iii. The Argument from Causal Exclusion

Most philosophers nowadays defend some version of non-reductive physicalism. According to non-reductive physicalism, all scientifically respectable entities are physical entities, where entities which cannot be straightforwardly reduced to physical entities—mental events or properties, for instance—are physical at least in the broad sense that they supervene or depend upon physical entities. Non-reductive physicalism is attractive because it promises to respect the naturalistic attitude characteristic of our modern scientific time while at the same time also preserving our self-conception as autonomous agents. For decades, however, Jaegwon Kim has argued that non-reductive physicalists unwittingly commit themselves to epiphenomenalism. His master argument is the so-called Causal Exclusion Argument, which he uses as a reductio ad absurdum of non-reductive physicalism: if the mental were merely supervenient upon but not reducible to the physical, as non-reductive physicalism holds, it would be causally irrelevant (barring overdetermination). Non-reductive physicalism is thus unable to steer a safe path between the Scylla of reductionism on the one hand and the Charybdis of epiphenomenalism on the other, so that those unwilling to embrace outright reductionism are forced to accept epiphenomenalism. Kim’s most recent version of the Causal Exclusion Argument, the so-called Supervenience Argument, has two stages. Stage one holds that mental properties (or, rather, their instances–a qualification that will be omitted from now on) can cause other mental properties only if they can cause physical properties. Stage two then holds that mental properties can cause physical properties only if they are reducible to physical properties or genuinely overdetermining. Since overdetermination can be ruled out, the only remaining alternatives are “reduction or causal impotence” (Kim 2005, 54). Suppose a mental property M causes a mental property M*. Since mind-body supervenience “is a shared minimum commitment of all positions that are properly called physicalist” (Kim 2005, 13), non-reductive physicalism must posit a physical supervenience base P* of M* which is (non-causally) sufficient for M*. What, then, is responsible for M*’s occurrence—M or P*? There appears to be “a tension between vertical determination and horizontal causation” (Kim 2003a, 153): “under the assumption of mind-body supervenience, M* occurs because its supervenience base P* occurs, and as long as P* occurs, M* must occur […] regardless of whether or not an instance of M preceded it. This puts the claim of M to be a cause of M* in jeopardy: P* alone seems fully responsible for, and capable of accounting for, the occurrence of M*” (Kim 1998, 42). The upshot of this first stage of the argument is that the tension between M and P* can be resolved only by accepting that “M caused M* by causing its supervenience base P*” (Kim 2005, 40). Stage two then goes on to argue that mental-to-physical causation is impossible. Given the so-called causal closure of the physical, P* must have a sufficient and completely physical cause P, leading to a competition between M and P for the role of P*’s cause. Barring overdetermination, M seems bound to loose this competition: if P is a sufficient cause of P*, then once P is instantiated all that is required for P* to occur is done and there is nothing left for M to contribute, causally speaking. This completes stage two of the Causal Exclusion Argument. Both steps together seem to lead to epiphenomenalism–unless mental properties are reducible or genuinely overdetermining, they must be causally inert, so that with the overdetermination option and the reduction option ruled out, epiphenomenalism is the inevitable consequence. In response, non-reductive physicalists have offered compatibilist accounts of mental causation designed to explain how irreducible mental properties can play a substantial causal role in the production of physical effects, given that the causal work is done solely by physical properties. The common core of these attempts is the idea that there is some compatibilist condition C such that (1.) fulfilling C is sufficient for being causally relevant; (2.) properties which do not do any real causal work can fulfill C; (3.) C can be fulfilled by two or more properties without leading to any kind of “causal competition;” and (4.) mental properties can fulfill C. Prominent compatibilist candidates for C include figuring in counterfactual dependencies (see LePore & Loewer 1987) or program explanations (see Jackson & Pettit 1990), being a determinable of the physical properties which do the causal work (see Yablo 1992), or falling under non-strict causal laws (see Fodor 1989; McLaughlin 1989).

c. Libet’s Experiments

Intuition tells us that we, as conscious selves, are in charge of our actions, and the man in the street finds the idea that consciousness is a causally irrelevant by-product of brain processes preposterous. Empirical scientists, however, have long questioned these assumptions. Many of them think that the brain causes our actions and then makes us think that it was us who did it: “The unique human convenience of conscious thoughts that preview our actions gives us the privilege of feeling we willfully cause what we do. In fact, unconscious and inscrutable mechanisms create both conscious thought about action and the action, and also produce the sense of will we experience by perceiving the thought as cause of the action” (Wegner 2002, 98). No empirical research has provoked more philosophical discussion than Benjamin Libet’s experiments concerning the relationship between unconscious brain activity and the subjective feeling of volition during the initiation of simple motor actions (see Libet et al. 1983; Libet 1985). Previous research had shown that actions that are perceived to be the result of a conscious feeling of volition are also preceded by a pattern of brain activity known as the “readiness potential.” The question Libet and his colleagues wanted to answer was: What comes first—the feeling of volition or the readiness potential? They instructed subjects to perform a simple motor activity, like pressing a button, within a certain time frame at an arbitrary moment decided by them (“Let the urge to act appear on its own any time without any preplanning or concentration on when to act”; Libet et al. 1983, 625). The subjects were asked to remember exactly when they made the decision, when they were first aware of the “urge to act,” by noticing the position of a dot circling a clock face (the “clock” being a cathode ray oscilloscope modified so as to be able to measure time intervals of roughly fifty milliseconds). The time when the action was carried out, when the subjects actually pressed the button, was measured by electronically recording the position of the dot. On average, it took about 200 milliseconds from the first conscious feeling of voliton to the actual pressing of the button. But Libet and his collaborators also recorded the subjects’ brain activity by means of an EEG. They found that an increased electrical activity, the so-called “readiness potential,” was built up (primarily in the secondary motor cortex) on average approximately 500 milliseconds before the button was pushed, and that means approximately 300 milliseconds before the subjects felt the conscious “urge to act” (Libet’s experiments have been repeated and improved several times; see, e.g. Keller & Heckhausen 1990; Haggard & Eimer 1999; Miller & Trevena 2002; Trevena & Miller 2002). It is tempting to interpret this result as showing that the allegedly free decision of the subject was in fact determined by unconscious brain processes and that, at least insofar as decisions to act are concerned, our mind is a mere epiphenomenon, but it remains a controversial issue exactly what philosophical consequences we ought to draw from Libet’s experiments (see Pockett et al. 2006).

5. Arguments against Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism has had few friends. It has been deemed “thoughtless and incoherent” (Taylor 1927, 198), “unintelligible” (Benecke 1901, 26), “quite impossible to believe” (Taylor 1963, 28) and “truly incredible” (McLaughlin 1994, 284). The resistance stems from the fact that many think that if epiphenomenalism were correct, we could not be the kind of being we are and we could not occupy the place in the world we occupy. We would instead be at the mercy of our brains and we would have to say that our actions are all our brains’ actions and that ultimately “we” have nothing to do with them.

If the eyebrows are raised they are not raised by us. What is done is not done by us. […] We go piggy-back, and we cannot get off. Where it goes, we go. What’s “it”? The body/brain is “it.” “It” is not us, is the point. Epiphenomenalism would be the ruin of the self and that self’s life. […] Our supposed self is illusory, and we are deluded. […] We lose ourselves when consciousness ceases to be effective in what we chose. (Hyslop 1998, 68)

In his book The Fundamental Questions of Philosophy, Alfred Cyril Ewing introduced epiphenomenalism as a theory that can be disposed of in a “conclusive fashion” (Ewing 1953, 127): “That epiphenomenalism is false is assumed in all practical life […] and it is silly to adopt a philosophy the denial of which is implied by us every time we do anything” (Ewing 1953, 128). But what exactly is it that renders epiphenomenalism so evidently absurd?

a. The Argument from Counterintuitiveness

Epiphenomenalism is counterintuitive. There’s no doubt about that. Yet, philosophy, like all science, is not concerned with intuitiveness but with truth, and that a theory is counterintuitive does not show that it is not true. In fact, a host of widely accepted and feted theories are counterintuitive at first and some remain so forever: the Copernican system, the Freudian theory of the unconscious, Einstein’s theories of special and general relativity or quantum mechanics. Einstein’s theory of relativity, for instance, is much less intuitive than Newtonian physics, but ultimately the fate of a theory depends on whether there are good arguments in favor of it, not on whether it is intuitive. If there are reasons for taking epiphenomenalism seriously, then we should do that, just as we do it in the case of the theory of relativity: “Epiphenomenalism may be counterintuitive, but it is not obviously false, so if a sound argument forces it on us, we should accept it” (Chalmers 1996, 159).

b. The Argument from Introspection

It might seem as if we can be introspectively aware of chains of mental occurrences, one of which is causing the other, for instance when we reason through an argument, write a piece of prose, or acquire a new belief by inferring it from previously held beliefs. We just know, it seems, that in these cases there is mental causation. The same may be said to be true of various chains of occurrences both inside and outside of our mind, for instance when volitions give rise to appropriate behavior, when a pain results in a wincing, or when fear makes our heart beat faster–one might say that in these cases, too, we have some immediate cognitive access to the causal efficacy of the mental. If we could indeed be in some sense “directly acquainted” with the fact that such sequences are the result of genuinely causal processes, epiphenomenalism would not be an option. Yet, our awareness of regular successions does not and cannot reveal their causal nature. The awareness of the psychological or psychophysical sequences that make up our everyday life is no more awareness of causal processes than awareness of the sequence of shadows a moving car casts (Lachs 1963, 189). Whatever those who hold that epiphenomenalism is “incompetent to take account of the obvious facts of mental life” (Taylor 1927, 198) mean, they cannot mean that it is contradicted by our immediate cognitive access to our mind’s causal effectiveness, because there is no phenomenological difference between a situation in which epiphenomenalism is false and a situation in which epiphenomenalism is true.

c. The Argument from Evolution

One of the earliest objections to epiphenomenalism starts with the observation that we have the properties we have because they contributed positively to our ancestors’ differential fitness and that a property which endows an organism with an evolutionary advantage must make a causal difference to its survival. Since we have mental properties, while our ancient ancestors did not, the argument continues, these properties must have evolved over time and therefore must be capable of making a causal difference (this argument is frequently attributed to Popper & Eccles 1977, but it was endorsed already by James 1879). Epiphenomenalists respond that mental properties may have evolved as nomologically necessary by-products of adaptive traits. A polar bear’s having a heavy coat decreases its fitness (by slowing it down), but is nevertheless an evolved trait because it was an inevitable by-product of a highly adaptive trait, namely, having a warm coat: “Having a heavy coat is an unavoidable concomitant of having a warm coat […], and the advantages for survival of having a warm coat outweighed the disadvantages of having a heavy one” (Jackson 1982, 134). Likewise, it could be that we enjoy our mental life because its neurophysiological causes contributed positively to our ancestors’ differential fitness by making them “fitter” compared to those who lacked such neurophysiological equipment. Maybe we have a mind because it was evolutionary adaptive to have a big brain and it is nomologically impossible to have a big brain without having a mind. The problem with this response is that while we understand perfectly well why polar bears can have warm coats only in virtue of having heavy coats, we have little or no idea why it should be necessary to have a mind in order to have a big brain. Why should of all neurophysiological structures only those with a causally irrelevant mind as by-product be able to do what was required for our ancestors’ survival? If a company claims that religion is not an employment criterion, but it turns out that all its employees are of the same religion, that cries out for an explanation, and the same holds if the epiphenomenalist claims that although our mind is totally ineffective, during the course of evolution only brain structures have evolved that are accompanied by a mind as a by-product.

d. The Argument from the Impossibility of Knowledge of Other Minds

Another problem is that epiphenomenalism seems to render our standard response to the other minds problem impossible. According to that response, our belief that our fellow human beings have a mental life similar to ours is justified by an argument from analogy, stated in its classic form by John Stuart Mill and Bertrand Russell (Mill 1865, 190-191; Russell 1948, 208-209 & 501-504). Since our own body and outward behavior are observably similar to the body and the behavior of our fellow human beings, we are justified by analogy in believing that they enjoy a mental life similar to ours. The idea is to infer like mental causes from like behavioral effects and this does not work for the epiphenomenalist who denies that there are any mental causes. (This is an objection to epiphenomenalism only if the argument from analogy does indeed provide a good solution to the other minds problem, and that is far from obvious–notoriously, inductions based on a single positive instance are problematic and in the case of other minds there is no independent way of verifying the conclusion.) The epiphenomenalist can employ the same strategy as in the case of the argument from evolution and insist that our inference to the mental life of others need not advert to causality all the way up. If the similar behavior and the similar body of others provide evidence for anything, they provide evidence for the assumption that they are in physical states relevantly similar to those which, in us, are causally responsible for our mental life. This inference is not one from outward behavior to inward mental causes, but from outward behavior to inward neurophysiological causes and from there on further to inward mental effects, but it seems that it is no less reliable (see Benecke 1901; Jackson 1982).

e. The Argument from Davidson’s Reasons for / Reasons for which Distinction

Davidson famously pointed out that I may have a reason for performing an action, perform that action, and yet not perform it for that reason (Davidson 1963, 9). Suppose, for instance, I want to meet my mistress and I believe that I can attain this goal by giving her a call; suppose I also have a second-order desire to get rid off my first-order desire and I believe that I can attain this goal by calling my psychiatrist. When I finally walk to the phone, it seems, I have a reason for doing so (my first-order desire plus my corresponding belief) which is not the reason for which I walk to phone (Wilson 1997, 72). According to Davidson, the reasons for an action and the reasons for which the action is performed can be easily distinguished: the reasons for which an action is performed are those which cause the action. This explanation is not available to the epiphenomenalist who holds that no reason ever causes an action. (Again, this is an objection against epiphenomenalism only if Davidson’s distinction makes sense; see Latham 2003 for the view that it doesn’t.) In response, however, the epiphenomenalist can hold that the reasons for which an action is performed are those that are caused by the neurophysiological cause of the action.

f. Other Arguments

Knowledge, memory, justification, meaning and reference all seem to require the causal efficacy of what is known, remembered, believed, meant or picked out. How, for instance, could we say that Sarah knows that there is orange juice in the fridge or that her belief that there is orange juice in the fridge is justified, if her belief were in no way causally connected to the fridge or the orange juice? The causal relation does not have to be direct–it may be that Sarah’s mother saw the orange juice in the fridge, told it to Sarah’s sister who in turn told it to Sarah, causing her thereby to believe that there is orange juice in the fridge. Most of our knowledge depends upon such indirect causal chains. We are not in direct causal contact with Plato, the cholera, Caesar’s crossing of the Rubicon or the outbreak of World War I, but we can have knowledge about these things because we are linked to them by long causal chains starting with someone who was in direct causal contact with them. According to a causal theory of knowledge, knowledge is impossible without such a causal chain, and something similar holds for justification, memory, meaning, and reference. If Sarah believes that it rained on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam, but the rain on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam is not causally related in any way to Sarah’s belief, then it seems that her belief cannot be justified; if the rain on that day is not causally related to Sarah’s current mental states in any way, then it seems that she cannot remember the rain on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam; and one reason why Sarah’s twin on Putnam’s famous Twin Earth (see Putnam 1975) cannot refer to water and why by using the word “water” she cannot mean water is that she never did causally interact with water. If knowledge, justification, memory, meaning and reference require a causal contact with what is known, believed, remembered, meant and picked out, epiphenomenalism implies that we cannot have knowledge of or justified beliefs about mental states (our own or those of others), that we cannot remember past mental states, cannot refer to mental states and cannot make meaningful statements about them. However, it is absurd to hold that Sarah cannot know that she is having a toothache, that she cannot remember the feeling she had when she fell in love for the first time etc. Moreover, if a causal theory of meaning or reference is correct, then the very statements the epiphenomenalist uses to formulate her position are meaningless: “if the mental contributes nothing to the way in which the linguistic practices involving ‘[psychological’ terms are developed and sustained in the speech-community […] then [this] would deprive the epiphenomenalist of the linguistic resources to enunciate his thesis” (Foster 1996, 191). To the extent that epiphenomenalism aspires to make a meaningful statement about the nature of our mental life, it would thus be self-refuting since that is impossible if it is true (see Robinson 2006 for a discussion of this problem and for a reply on behalf of epiphenomenalism). Even if the epiphenomenalist could somehow formulate her position, it would be a pointless exercise from her point of view to try to convince us of its truth, because if she is right, rational considerations can have no causal influence upon our beliefs and actions. In response, the epiphenomenalist could argue that a causal chain cannot always be required because Sarah can know, justifiably believe or remember that bachelors are unmarried and that two plus two equals four, or use the term “the biggest star in the universe” to refer to an object even if she never causally interacted with bachelors, the number two or the biggest star in the universe. The problem, however, is that our knowledge and our memories of and our talk about our mental states seem to be fundamentally different from the typical examples of knowledge, memory, or reference that are possible without a causal contact. As Dieter Birnbacher points out (before he goes on the defend epiphenomenalism against this charge): “[such] examples show that a causal theory of knowledge cannot claim to cover all and every kind of knowledge. But this doesn’t mean that a causal theory of knowledge is implausible for other, and admittedly central, kinds of knowledge such as knowledge by perception and introspection” (Birnbacher 2006, 123-124). The epiphenomenalist has to offer a constructive account of what, if not a causal relation, grounds knowledge, justification, memory, meaning, and reference in the case of mental states. According to David Chalmers, for instance, in the case of phenomenal mental states, knowledge and justification are an immediate consequence of the fact that we have these experiences: “it is having the experiences that justifies the beliefs [about our experiences]” (Chalmers 1996, 196), because “[t]o have an experience is automatically to stand in some sort of intimate epistemic relation to the experience” (Chalmers 1996, 196-197). Since the epiphenomenalist admits that we have experiences and since we cannot have experiences without knowing that we have them, the epiphenomenalist can admit that we can have knowledge of our experiences. Chalmers also develops a non-causal account of memory and reference (Chalmers 1996, 192-203; see Robinson 1982, 2006 for competing but related proposals). Although there may be problems with such accounts, it certainly seems plausible to ask why the opponents of epiphenomenalism insist that the relation that grounds knowledge, justification, memory, reference and meaning must be causal through and through. According to the epiphenomenalist, when Sarah knows that she has a toothache or remembers the feeling she had when she first fell in love, there is a causal chain which leads from the neurophysiological cause of her toothache or her feeling to her current state of knowledge or memory. Why should such a chain be less capable of grounding knowledge or memory than a causal chain which starts with the toothache or the feeling itself? To insist without further explanation that the link has to be causal through and through does not tell us what the apparently indispensable je-ne-sais-quois about such a causal link is, without which knowledge, memory etc. are supposed to be impossible (see Pauen 2006 and Staudacher 2006 for further discussion). There are various objections against epiphenomenalism, nearly all of which are based upon the claim that this or that undeniable fact would be impossible if epiphenomenalism were true. In response, the epiphenomenalist typically points out that the causal relation she says holds between mental states and their neurophysiological correlates ensures that whenever her opponents appeal to a mental cause to account for some apparently undeniable fact, she can appeal to a physical cause which is correlated with the alleged mental cause with nomological necessity and does exactly the same causal job.

6. References and Further Reading

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  • Birnbacher, D. (2006). Causal interpretations of correlations between neural and conscious events. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 115-128.
  • Bonnet, C. (1755). Essai de Psychologie. Ou Considerations de l’Ame, sur l’Habitude et sur l’Education. London. Reprinted 1978, Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag.
  • Burge, T. (1979). Individualism and the mental. Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4, 73-121.
  • Burge, T. (1993). Mind-body causation and explanatory practice, Mental Causation, hrsg. v. J. Heil & A. Mele, 97-120. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Campbell, N. (1997). Anomalous monism and the charge of epiphenomenalism. Dialectica, 52, 23-39.
  • Campbell, N. (1998). The standard objection to anomalous monism. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 75, 373-382.
  • Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind: In Search of a Fundamental Theory. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Davidson, D. (1963). Actions, reasons, and causes. Journal of Philosophy, 60, 685-700. Reprinted in Essays on Actions and Events, 3-19. Oxford: Clarendon Press 1980.
  • Davidson, D. (1970). Mental events, Experience and Theory, ed. L. Foster & J.W. Swanson, 79-101. Amherst, MA: The University of Massachusetts Press and Duckworth. Reprinted in Essays on Actions and Events, 207-225. Oxford: Clarendon Press 1980.
  • Davidson, D. (1993). Thinking causes, Mental Causation, ed. J. Heil A. Mele, 3-17. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Dretske, F. (1988). Explaining Behavior: Reasons in a World of Causes. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Dretske, F. (1989). Reasons and causes. Philosophical Perspectives, 3, 1-15.
  • Ewing, A. (1953). The Fundamental Problems of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan.
  • Fodor, J. (1987). Psychosemantics. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Fodor, J. (1989). Making mind matter more. Philosophical Topics, 17, 59-79. Reprinted in A Theory of Content and Other Essays, 137-160. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press 1990.
  • Fodor, J. (1991). A modal argument for narrow content. Journal of Philosophy, 88, 5-26.
  • Fodor, J. (1995). The Elm and the Expert: Mentalese and its Semantics. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Foster, J. (1996). The Immaterial Self. London: Routledge.
  • Haggard, P. & Eimer, M. (1999). On the relation between brain potentials and the awareness of voluntary movements. Experimental Brain Research, 126, 128-133.
  • Hodgson, S. (1965). Time and Space: A Metaphysical Essay. London: Longmans, Green.
  • Honderich, T. (1982). The argument for anomalous monism. Analysis, 42, 59-64.
  • Huxley, T.H. (1874). On the hypothesis that animals are automata, and its history. Fortnightly Review, 22, 555-580. Reprinted in Collected Essays: Volume I, Method and Results, 195-250. London: Macmillan 1893.
  • Huxley, T.H. (1898). Hume with Helps to the Study of Berkeley. New York: D. Appleton and Company.
  • Hyslop, A. (1998). Methodological epiphenomenalism. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 76, 61-70.
  • Jackson, F. (1982). Epiphenomenal qualia. Philosophical Quarterly, 32, 127-136.
  • Jackson, F. & Pettit, P. (1990). Program explanation: A general perspective. Analysis, 50, 107-117.
  • James, W. (1879). Are we automata? Mind, 4, 1-22.
  • Keller, I. & Heckhausen, H. (1990). Readiness potentials preceding spontaneous motor acts: Voluntary vs. involuntary control. Electroencephalography and Clinical Neurophysiology, 76, 351-361.
  • Kim, J. (1989a). The myth of nonreductive materialism. Proceedings of the American Philosophical Association, 63, 31-47. Reprinted in Supervenience and Mind: Selected Philosophical Essays, 265-284. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press 1993.
  • Kim, J. (1993a). Can supervenience and ‘non-strict laws’ save anomalous monism?, Mental Causation, ed. J. Heil & A. Mele, 19-26. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Kim, J. (1998). Mind in a Physical World: An Essay on the Mind-Body Problem and Mental Causation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Kim, J. (2003a). Blocking causal drainage and other maintenance chores with mental causation. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 67, 151-176.
  • Kim, J. (2003b). Philosophy of psychology, Donald Davidson, ed. K. Ludwig, 113-136. Oxford: Clarendon.
  • Kim, J. (2005). Physicalism – Or Something Near Enough. Cambridge, MA: Princeton University Press.
  • Lachs, J. (1963). The impotent mind. Review of Metaphysics, 17, 187-199.
  • Latham, N. (2003). Are there any nonmotivating reasons for action?, Physicalism and Mental Causation: The Metaphysics of Mind and Action, ed. S. Walter & H.D. Heckmann, 273-294. Thoverton: Imprint Academic.
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  • Libet, B., Gleason, C., Wright, E. & Pearl, D. (1983). Time of conscious intention to act in relation to onset of cerebral activities (readiness-potential): The unconscious initiation of a freely voluntary act. Brain, 106, 623-642.
  • McLaughlin, B. (1989). Type epiphenomenalism, type dualism, and the causal priority of the physical. Philosophical Perspectives, 3, 109-135.
  • McLaughlin, B. (1994). Epiphenomenalism, A Companion to the Philosophy of Mind, ed. S. Guttenplan, 277-288. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Mill, J.S. (1865). An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy. Collected Works of John Stuart Mill, Vol. 9, ed. J.M. Robson. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1979.
  • Miller, J. & Trevena, J. (2002). Cortical movement preparation and conscious decisions: Averaging artifacts and timing biases. Consciousness and Cognition, 11, 308-313.
  • Pauen, M. (2006). Feeling causes. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 129-152.
  • Pockett, S., Banks, W. & Gallagher, S. (2006). Does Consciousness Cause Behavior? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Popper, K. & Eccles, J. (1977). The Self and Its Brain. New York: Springer.
  • Putnam, H. (1975). The meaning of ‘meaning’. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, 7, 131-193. Reprinted in Mind, Language, and Reality: Philosophical Papers, Vol. 2, 215-271. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press 1975.
  • Robinson, W. (1982). Causation, sensations and knowledge. Mind, 91, 524-540.
  • Robinson, W. (2003). Epiphenomenalism, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2003 Edition), ed. by E. Zalta.
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Author Information

Sven Walter
Email: s.walter@philosophy-online.de
University of Bielefeld
Germany

Confirmation and Induction

The term “confirmation” is used in epistemology and the philosophy of science whenever observational data and evidence “speak in favor of” or support scientific theories and everyday hypotheses. Historically, confirmation has been closely related to the problem of induction, the question of what to believe regarding the future in the face of knowledge that is restricted to the past and present. One view of the relation between confirmation and induction is that the conclusion H of an inductively strong argument with premise E is confirmed by E. If inductive strength comes in degrees and the inductive strength of the argument with premise E and conclusion H is equal to r, then the degree of confirmation of H by E is likewise said to be equal to r.

This article begins by briefly reviewing Hume‘s formulation of the problem of the justification of induction. Then it jumps to the middle of the twentieth century and Hempel‘s pioneering work on confirmation. After looking at Popper’s falsificationism and the hypothetico-deductive method of hypotheses testing, the notion of probability, as it was defined by Kolmogorov, is introduced. Probability theory is the main mathematical tool for Carnap‘s inductive logic as well as for Bayesian confirmation theory. Carnap’s inductive logic is based on a logical interpretation of probability, which is discussed at some length. However, his heroic efforts to construct a logical probability measure in purely syntactical terms can be considered to have failed. Goodman’s new riddle of induction serves to illustrate the shortcomings of such a purely syntactical approach to confirmation. Carnap’s work is nevertheless important because today’s most popular theory of confirmation—Bayesian confirmation theory—is to a great extent the result of replacing Carnap’s logical interpretation of probability with a subjective interpretation as degree of belief qua fair betting ratio. The rest of the article mainly is concerned with Bayesian confirmation theory, although the final section mentions some alternative views on confirmation and induction.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction: Confirmation and Induction
  2. Hempel and the Logic of Confirmation
    1. The Ravens Paradox
    2. The Logic of Confirmation
  3. Popper’s Falsificationism and Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation
    1. Popper’s Falsificationism
    2. Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation
  4. Inductive Logic
    1. Kolmogorov’s Axiomatization
    2. Logical Probability and Degree of Confirmation
    3. Absolute and Incremental Confirmation
    4. Carnap’s Analysis of Hempel’s Conditions
  5. The New Riddle of Induction and the Demise of the Syntactic Approach
  6. Bayesian Confirmation Theory
    1. Subjective Probability and the Dutch Book Argument
    2. Confirmation Measures
    3. Some Success Stories
  7. Taking Stock
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction: Confirmation and Induction

Whenever observational data and evidence speak in favor of, or support, scientific theories or everyday hypotheses, the latter are said to be confirmed by the former. The positive result of an allergy test speaks in favor of, or confirms, the hypothesis that the tested person has the allergy that is tested for. The dark clouds on the sky support, or confirm, the hypothesis that it will be raining soon.

Confirmation takes a qualitative and a quantitative form. Qualitative confirmation is usually construed as a relation, among other things, between three sentences or propositions: evidence E confirms hypothesis H relative to background information B. Quantitative confirmation is, among other things, a relation between evidence E, hypothesis H, background information B, and a number r: E confirms H relative to B to degree r. (Comparative confirmation—H1 is more confirmed by E1 relative to B1 than H2 by E2 relative to B2—is usually derived from a quantitative notion of confirmation, and is not discussed in this article.)

Historically, confirmation has been closely related to the problem of induction, the question of what to believe regarding the future in the face of knowledge that is restricted to the past and present. David Hume gives the classic formulation of the problem of the justification of induction in A Treatise of Human Nature:

Let men be once fully persuaded of these two principles, that there is nothing in any object, consider’d in itself, which can afford us a reason for drawing a conclusion beyond it; and, that even after the observation of the frequent or constant conjunction of objects, we have no reason to draw any inference concerning any object beyond those of which we have had experience; (Hume 1739/2000, book 1, part 3, section 12)

The reason is that any such inference beyond those objects of which we had experience needs to be justified—and, according to Hume, this is not possible.

In order to justify induction one has to provide a deductively valid argument, or an inductively strong argument, whose premises we know to be true, and whose conclusion says that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions (most of the time). (An argument consists of a list of premises P1, …, Pn and a conclusion C. An argument is deductively valid just in case the truth of the premises logically guarantees the truth of the conclusion. There is no standard definition of an inductively strong argument, but the idea is that the truth of all premises speaks in favor of, or supports, the truth of conclusion.) However, there is no deductively valid argument whose premises we know to be true and whose conclusion says that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions (most of the time). This is so, because all our knowledge is restricted to the past and present, the relevant conclusion is in part about the future, and it is a fact of logic that there are no deductively valid arguments whose premises are restricted to the past and present and whose conclusion is in part about the future. Furthermore, any inductively strong argument presumably has to be inductively strong in the sense of the very principle of induction that is to be justified—and thus begs the question: it is a petitio principii, an argument that presupposes the principle that it derives. For more, see the introductory Skyrms (2000), the intermediate Hacking (2001), and the advanced Howson (2000a).

Neglecting the background information B, as we will mostly do in the following, we can state the link between induction and confirmation as follows. The conclusion H of an inductively strong argument with premise E is confirmed by E. If r quantifies the strength of the inductive argument in question, the degree of confirmation of H by E is equal to r. Let us then start the discussion of confirmation by the first serious attempts to define the notion, and to develop a corresponding logic of confirmation.

2. Hempel and the Logic of Confirmation

a. The Ravens Paradox

According to the Nicod criterion of confirmation (Hempel 1945), universal generalizations of the form “All Fs are Gs,” in symbols ∀x(Fx  → Gx), are confirmed by their instances “This particular object a is both F and G,” or in symbols Fa ∧ Ga. (It would be more appropriate to call FaGa rather than Fa ∧ Ga an instance of ∀x(Fx Gx).) The universal generalization “All ravens are black” is thus said to be confirmed by its instance “a is a black raven.” As “a is a non-black non-raven” is an instance of “All non-black things are non-ravens,” the Nicod criterion says that “a is a non-black non-raven” confirms “All non-black things are non-ravens.” (It is sometimes said that a black raven confirms the ravens hypothesis “All ravens are black.” In this case, confirmation is a relation between a non-linguistic entity—namely, a black raven—and a hypothesis. Conformation is construed as a relation between, among other things, evidential propositions and hypotheses, and so we have to state the above in a clumsier way.)

One of Hempel’s conditions of adequacy for any relation of confirmation is the equivalence condition. It says that logically equivalent hypotheses are confirmed by the same evidential propositions. “All ravens are black” is logically equivalent to “All non-black things are non-ravens.” Therefore a non-black non-raven like a white shoe or a red herring can be used to confirm the ravens-hypothesis “All ravens are black.” Surely, this is absurd—and this is known as the ravens paradox.

Even worse, “All ravens are black,” ∀x(RxBx), is logically equivalent to “All things that are green or not green are not ravens or black,”∀x[(Gx ∨ ¬Gx) → (¬Rx ∨ Bx)]. “a is green or not green, and a is not raven or black” is an instance of this hypothesis. Furthermore, it is logically equivalent to “a is not a raven or a is black.” As everything is green or not green, we get the similarly paradoxical result that an object which is not a raven or which is black—anything but a non-black raven which could be used to falsify the ravens hypothesis is such an object—can be used to confirm the ravens hypothesis that all ravens are black.

Hempel (1945), who discussed these cases of the ravens, concluded that non-black non-ravens (as well as any other object that is not a raven or black) can indeed be used to confirm the ravens hypothesis. He attributed the paradoxical character of this alleged paradox to the psychological fact that we assume there to be far more non-black objects than ravens. However, the notion of confirmation he was explicating was supposed to presuppose no background knowledge whatsoever. An example by Good (1967) shows that such an unrelativized notion of confirmation is not useful (see Hempel 1967, Good 1968).

Others have been led to the rejection of the Nicod criterion. Howson (2000b, 113) considers the hypothesis “Everybody in the room leaves with somebody else’s hat,” which he attributes to Rosenkrantz (1981). If the background contains the information that there are only three individuals a, b, c in the room, then the evidence consisting of the two instances “a leaves with b‘s hat” and “b leaves with a‘s hat” falsifies rather than confirms the hypothesis. Besides pointing to the role played by the background information in this example, Hempel would presumably have stressed that the Nicod criterion has to be restricted to universal generalization in one variable only. Already in his (1945, 13: fn. 1) he notes that R(a, b) ∧ ¬R(a, b) falsifies ∀xy(¬[R(x, y) ∧ R(y, x)] → [R(x, y) ∧ ¬R(x, y)]), which is equivalent to ∀x∀xR(x, y), although it satisfies both the antecedent and the consequent of the universal generalization (compare also Carnap 1950/1962, 469f).

b. The Logic of Confirmation

After discussing the ravens, Hempel (1945) considers the following conditions of adequacy for any relation of confirmation:

  1. Entailment Condition: If an evidential proposition E logically implies some hypothesis H, then E confirms H.
  2. Special Consequence Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H logically implies some hypothesis H’, then E also confirms H’.
  3. Special Consistency Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H is not compatible with some hypothesis H’, then E does not confirm H’.
  4. Converse Consequence Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H is logically implied by some hypothesis H’, then E also confirms H’.

(The equivalence condition mentioned above follows from 2 as well as from 4). Hempel then shows that any relation of confirmation satisfying 1, 2, and 4 is trivial in the sense that every evidential proposition E confirms every hypothesis H. This is easily seen as follows. As E logically implies itself, E confirms E according to the entailment condition. The conjunction of E and H, ∧ H, logically implies E, and so the converse consequence condition entails that E confirms ∧ H. But ∧ H logically implies H; thus E confirms H by the special consequence condition. In fact, it suffices that confirmation satisfies 1 and 4 in order to be trivial: E logically implies and, by 1, confirms the disjunction of E and H, ∨ H. As H logically implies ∨ H, E confirms H by 4.

Hempel (1945) rejects the converse consequence condition as the culprit rendering trivial any relation of confirmation satisfying 1-4. The latter condition has nevertheless gained popularity in the philosophy of science—partly because it seems to be at the core of the account of confirmation we will discuss next.

3. Popper’s Falsificationism and Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation

a. Popper’s Falsificationism

Although Popper was an opponent of any kind of induction, his falsificationism gave rise to a qualitative account of confirmation. Popper started by observing that many scientific hypotheses have the form of universal generalizations, say “All metals conduct electricity.” Now there can be no amount of observational data that would verify a universal generalization. After all, the next piece of metal could be such that it does not conduct electricity. In order to verify this hypothesis we would have to investigate all pieces of metal there are—and even if there were only finitely many such pieces, we would never know this (unless there were only finitely many space-time regions we would have to search). Popper’s basic insight is that these universal generalizations can be falsified, though. We only need to find a piece of metal that does not conduct electricity in order to know that our hypothesis is false (supposing we can check this). Popper then generalized this. He suggested that all science should put forth bold hypotheses, which are then severely tested (where ‘bold’ means to have many observational consequences). As long as these hypotheses survive their tests, scientists should stick to them. However, once they are falsified, they should be put aside if there are competing hypotheses that remain unfalsified.

This is not the place to list the numerous problems of Popper’s falsificationism. Suffice it to say that there are many scientific hypotheses that are neither verifiable nor falsifiable, and that falsifying instances are often taken to be indicators of errors that lie elsewhere, say errors of measurement or errors in auxiliary hypotheses. As Duhem and Quine noted, confirmation is holistic in the sense that it is always a whole battery of hypotheses that is put to test, and the arrow of error usually does not point to a single hypothesis (Duhem 1906/1974, Quine 1953).

According to Popper’s falsificationism (see Popper 1935/1994) the hallmark of scientific (rather than meaningful, as in the early days of logical positivism) hypotheses is that they are falsifiable: scientific hypotheses must have consequences whose truth or falsity can in principle (and with a grain of salt) be ascertained by observation (with a grain of salt, because for Popper there is always an element of convention in stipulating the basis of science). If there are no conditions under which a given hypothesis is false, this hypothesis is not scientific (though it may very well be meaningful).

b. Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation

The hypothetico-deductive notion of confirmation says that an evidential proposition E confirms a hypothesis H relative to background information B if and only if the conjunction of H and B, H B, logically implies E in some suitable way (which depends on the particular version of hypothetic-deductivism under consideration). The intuition here is that scientific hypotheses are tested; and if a hypothesis H survives a severe test, then, intuitively, this is evidence in favor of H. Furthermore, scientific hypotheses are often used for predictions. If a hypothesis H correctly predicts some experimental outcome E by logically implying it, then, intuitively, this is again evidence for the truth of H. Both of these related aspects are covered by the above definition, if surviving a test is tantamount to entailing the correct outcome.

Note that hypthetico-deductive confirmation—henceforth HD-confirmation—satisfies Hempel’s converse consequence condition. Suppose an evidential proposition E HD-confirms some hypothesis H. This means that H logically implies E in some suitable way. Now any hypothesis H’ which logically implies H also logically implies E. But this means—at least under most conditions fixing the “suitable way” of entailment—that E HD-confirms H’.

Hypothetico-deductivism has run into serious difficulties. To mention just two, there is the problem of irrelevant conjunctions and the problem of irrelevant disjunctions. Suppose an evidential proposition E HD-confirms some hypothesis H. Then, by the converse consequence condition, E also HD-confirms ∧ H’, for any hypothesis H’ whatsoever. Assuming that the anomalous perihelion of Mercury confirms the general theory of relativity GTR (Earman 1992), it also confirms the conjunction of GTR and, say, that there is life on Mars—which seems to be wrong. Similarly, if E HD-confirms H, then ∨ E’ HD-confirms H, for any evidential proposition E’ whatsoever. For instance, the disjunctive proposition of the anomalous perihelion of Mercury or the moon’s being made of cheese HD-confirms GTR (Grimes 1990, Moretti 2004).

Another worry with HD-confirmation is that it is not clear how it should be applied to statistical hypotheses that do not entail anything that is not probabilistic, and hence they entail nothing that is observable (see, however, Albert 1992). The treatment of statistical hypotheses is no problem for probabilistic theories of confirmation, which we will turn to now.

4. Inductive Logic

For overview articles see Fitelson (2005) and Hawthorne (2005).

a. Kolmogorov’s Axiomatization

Before we turn to inductive logic, let us define the notion of probability as it was axiomatized by Kolmogorov (1933; 1956).

Let W be a non-empty set (of outcomes or possibilities), and let A be a field over W, that is, a set of subsets of W that contains the whole set W and is closed under complementation (with respect to W) and finite unions. That is, A is a field over W if and only if A is a set of subsets of W such that

(i) WA

(ii) if AA, then (W\A) = –AA

(iii) if AA and BA, then (A ∪ B) ∈ A

where “W\A” is the complement of A with respect to W. If (iii) is strengthened to

(iv) if A1A, … AnA, …, then (A1∪…∪An∪…) ∈ A,

so that A is closed under countable (and not only finite) unions, A is called a σ-field over W.

A function Pr: A → ℜ from the field A over W into the real numbers ℜ is a (finitely additive) probability measure on A if and only if it is a non-negative, normalized, and (finitely) additive measure; that is, if and only if for all A, BA

(K1) Pr(A) ≥ 0

(K2) Pr(W) = 1

(K3) if AB = ∅, then Pr(A∪ B) = Pr(A) + Pr(B)

The triple <W, A, Pr> with W a non-empty set, A a field over W, and Pr a probability measure on A is called a (finitely additive) probability space. If A is a σ-field over W and Pr: A → ℜ additionally satisfies

(K4) if A1A2 ⊇ … ⊇ An … is a decreasing sequence of elements of A, i.e. A1A, … AnA, …, such that A1A2∩…∩An∩… = ∅, then limn→∞ Pr(An) = 0,

Pr is a σ-additive probability measure on A and <W, A, Pr> is a σ-additive probability space (Kolmogorov 1933; 1956, ch. 2). (K4) asserts that

limn→∞ Pr(An) = Pr(A1A2∩…∩An∩…) = Pr(∅) = 0

for a decreasing sequence of elements of A. Given (K1-3), (K4) is equivalent to

(K5) if A1A, … AnA, …, and if AiAj= ∅ for all natural numbers i, j with i j, then Pr(A1∪…∪An∪…) = Pr(A1) + … + Pr(An) + …

A probability measure Pr: A → ℜ on A is regular just in case Pr(A) > 0 for every non-empty AA. Let <W, A, Pr> be a probability space, and define A* to be the set of all AA that have positive probability according to Pr, that is, A* = {AA: Pr(A) > 0}. The conditional probability measure Pr(•|-): A x A* → ℜ on A (based on the unconditional probability measure Pr) is defined for all AA and BA* by the fraction

(K6) Pr(A|B) = Pr(AB)/Pr(B)

(Kolmogorov 1933; 1956, ch. 1, §4). The domain of the second argument place of Pr(•|-) has to be restricted to A*, since the fraction Pr(AB)/Pr(B) is not defined when Pr(B) = 0. Note that Pr(•|B): A → ℜ is a probability measure on A, for every BA*.

Here are some immediate consequences of the Kolmogorov axioms and the definition of conditional probability. For every probability space <W, A, Pr> and all A, BA,

  • Law of Negation: Pr(-A)= 1 – Pr(A)
  • Law of Conjunction: Pr(AB) = Pr(B)•Pr(A|B) whenever Pr(B) > 0
  • Law of Disjunction: Pr(AB) = Pr(A) + Pr(B) – Pr(AB)
  • Law of Total Probability: Pr(B) = ΣiPr(B|Ai)•Pr(Ai),

where the Ai form a countable partition of W, i.e. A1, … An, … is a sequence of mutually exclusive (AiAj= ∅ for all i, j with i j) and jointly exhaustive (A1∪…∪An∪… = W) elements of A. A special case of the Law of Total Probability is

Pr(B) = Pr(B|A)•Pr(A) + Pr(B|-A)•Pr(-A).

Finally the definition of conditional probability is easily turned into

Bayes’s Theorem: Pr(A|B) = Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/Pr(B)

= Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/[Pr(B|A)•Pr(A) + Pr(B|-A)•Pr(-A)]

= Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/ΣiPr(B|Ai)•Pr(Ai),

where the Ai form a countable partition of W. The important role played by Bayes’s Theorem (in combination with some principle linking objective chances and subjective probabilities) for confirmation will be discussed below. For more on Bayes’s Theorem see Joyce (2003).

The names of the first three laws above indicate that probability measures can also be defined on formal languages. Instead of defining probability on a field A over some non-empty set W, we can take its domain to be a formal language L, that is, a set of (possibly open) well-formed formulas that contains the tautological sentence τ (corresponding to the whole set W) and is closed under negation ¬ (corresponding to complementation) and disjunction ∨ (corresponding to finite union). That is, L is a language if and only if L is a set of well-formed formulas such that

(i) τL

(ii) if αL, then ¬α ∈ L

(iii) if αL and βL, then (α∨ β) ∈ L

If L additionally satisfies

(iv) if αL, then ∃ L,

L is called a quantificational language.

A function Pr: L → ℜ from the language L into the reals ℜ is a probability on L if and only if for all α, βL,

(L0) Pr(α) = Pr(β) if α is logically equivalent (in the sense of classical logic CL) to β

(L1) Pr(α) ≥ 0,

(L2) Pr(τ) = 1,

(L3) Pr(α∨ β) = Pr(α) + Pr(β), if α∧ β is logically inconsistent (in the sense of CL).

(L0) is not necessary, if (L2) is strengthened to: (L2+) Pr(α) = 1, if α is logically valid. If L is a quantificational language with an individual constant “ai” for each individual ai in the envisioned countable domain, i = 1, 2, …, n, …, and Pr: L → ℜ additionally satisfies

(L4) limn→∞Pr(α[a1/x]∧…∧α[an/x]) = Pr(∀),

Pr is called a Gaifman-Snir probability. Here “α[ai/x]” results from “α[x]” by substituting the individual constant “ai” for all occurrences of the individual variable “x” in “α.” “x” in “α[x]” indicates that “x” occurs free in “α,” that is to say, “x” is not bound in “α” by a quantifier like it is in “∀.”

Given (L0-3) and the restriction to countable domains, (L4) is equivalent to

(L5) limn→∞Pr(α[a1/x]∨…∨α[an/x]) = sup{Pr(α[a1/x]∨…∨α[an/x]): nN} =
Pr
(∃),

where the equation on the right-hand side is the slightly more general definition adopted by Gaifman & Snir (1982, 501). A probability Pr: L → ℜ on L is regular just in case Pr(α) > 0 for every consistent αL. For L* = {αL: Pr(α) > 0} the conditional probability Pr(•|-): L x L* → ℜ on L (based on Pr) is defined for all αL and all βL* by the fraction

(L6) Pr(α|β) = Pr(α∧ β)/Pr(β).

As before, Pr(•|β): L → ℜ is a probability on L, for every βL.

Each probability Pr on a language L induces a probability space <W, A, Pr*> with W being the set Mod of all models for L, A being the smallest σ-field containing the field {Mod(α) ⊆Mod: αL}, and Pr* being the unique σ-additive probability measure on A such that Pr*(Mod(α)) = Pr(α) for all αL. (A model for a language L with an individual constant for each individual in the envisioned domain can be represented by a function w: L → {0,1} from L into the set {0,1} such that for all α, βL: w(¬α) = 1 – w(α), w(αβ) = max{w(α), w(β)}, and w(∃) = max{w(α[a/x]): “a” is an individual constant of L}.)

Some authors take conditional probability Pr(• given -) as primitive and define probability as Pr(• given W) or Pr(• given τ) (see Hájek 2003b). For more on probability and its interpretations see Hájek (2003a), Hájek & Hall (2000), Fitelson & Hájek & Hall (2005).

b. Logical Probability and Degree of Confirmation

There has always been a close connection between probability and induction. Probability was thought to provide the basis for an inductive logic. Early proponents of a logical conception of probability include Keynes (1921/1973) and Jeffreys (1939/1967). However, by far the biggest effort to construct an inductive logic was undertaken by Carnap in his Logical Foundations of Probability (1950/1962). Carnap starts from a simple formal language with countably many individual constants (such as “Carl Gustav Hempel”) denoting individuals (namely, Carl Gustav Hempel) and finitely many monadic predicates (such as “is a great philosopher of science”) denoting properties (namely, being a great philosopher of science), but not relations (such as being a better philosopher of science than). Then he defines a state-description to be a complete description of each individual with respect to all the predicates. For instance, if the language contains three individual constants “a,” “b,” and “c” (denoting the individuals a, b, and c, respectively), and four monadic predicates “P,” “Q,” “R,” and “S” (denoting the properties P,  Q,  R, and S, respectively), then there are 23•4 state descriptions of the form:

±Pa ∧ ±Qa ∧ ±Ra ∧ ±Sa ∧ ±Pb ∧ ±Qb ∧ ±Rb ∧ ±Sb ∧ ±Pc ∧ ±Qc ∧ ±Rc ∧ ±Sc,

where “±” indicates that the predicate in question is either unnegated as in “Pa” or negated as in “¬Pa.” That is, a state description determines for each individual constant “a” and each predicate “P” whether or not Pa. Based on the notion of a state description, Carnap then introduces the notion of a structure description, a maximal disjunction of state descriptions which can be obtained from each other by uniformly substituting individual constants for each other. In the above example there are, among others, the following two structure descriptions:

(Pa ∧ Qa ∧ Ra Sa) ∧ (Pb ∧ Qb ∧ Rb ∧ Sb) ∧ (Pc ∧ Qc ∧ Rc ∧ Sc)

((Pa ∧ QaRaSa) ∧ (PbQbRb ∧ ¬Sb) ∧ (PcQc ∧ ¬RcSc)) ∨((PbQbRbSb) ∧ (PaQaRa ∧ ¬Sa) ∧ (PcQc ∧ ¬RcSc)) ∨((PcQcRcSc) ∧ (PbQbRb ∧ ¬Sb) ∧ (PaQa ∧ ¬RaSa)) ∨((PaQaRaSa) ∧ (PcQcRc ∧ ¬Sc) ∧ (PbQb ∧ ¬RbSb))

So a structure description is a disjunction of one or more state descriptions. It says how many individuals satisfy the maximally consistent predicates (Carnap calls them Q-predicates) that can be formulated in the language. It may, but need not, say which individuals. The first structure description above says that all three individuals a, b, and c have the maximally consistent property Px Qx Rx Sx. The second structure description says that exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px Qx Rx Sx, exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px Qx Rx ∧ ¬Sx, and exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px Qx ∧ ¬Rx Sx. It does not say which of a, b, and c has the property in question.

Each function that assigns non-negative weights wi to the state descriptions zi whose sum Σiwi equals 1 induces a probability on the language in question. Carnap then argues—by postulating various principles of symmetry and invariance—that each of the finitely many structure (not state) descriptions sj should be assigned the same weight vj such that their sum Σjvj is equal to 1. This weight vj should then be divided equally among the state descriptions whose disjunction constitutes the structure description sj. The probability so obtained is Carnap’s favorite m*, which, like any other probability, induces what Carnap calls a confirmation function (and what we have called a conditional probability): c*(H, E) = m*(E)/m*(E)

(In case the language contains countably infinitely many individual constants, some structure descriptions are disjunctions of infinitely many state descriptions. These state descriptions cannot all get the same positive weight. Therefore Carnap considers the limit of the measures m*n for the languages Ln containing the first n individual constants in some enumeration of the individual constants, provided this limit exists.)

c* allows learning from experience in the sense that

c*(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) > c*(the n + 1st individual is P, τ)

= m*(the n + 1st individual is P),

where τ is the tautological sentence. If we assigned equal weights to the state descriptions instead of the structure descriptions, no such learning would be possible. Let us check that c* allows learning from experience for n = 2 in a language with three individual constants “a,” “b,” and “c” and one predicate “P.” There are eight state descriptions and four structure descriptions:

z1 = Pa Pb Pc s1 = Pa Pb Pc:
z2 = Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc All three individuals are P.
z3 = Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc s2 = (Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc)∨(¬Pa Pb Pc):
z4 = Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc Exactly two individuals are P.
z5 = ¬Pa Pb Pc s3 = (Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc):
z6 = ¬Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc Exactly one individual is P.
z7 = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc s4 = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc:
z8 = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc None of the three individuals is P.

Each structure description s1s4 gets weight vj = 1/4 (j = 1, …, 4).

s1 = z1: v1 = m*(Pa Pb Pc) = 1/4

s2 = z2z3z5: v2 = m*((Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc)∨(¬Pa Pb Pc)) = 1/4

s3 = z4z6z7: v3 = m*((Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc)) = 1/4

s4 = z8: v4 = m*Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/4

These weights are equally divided among the state descriptions z1z8.

z1: w1 = m*(Pa Pb Pc) = 1/4 z5: w5 = m*Pa PbPc) = 1/12

z2: w2 = m*(Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12 z6: w6 = m*Pa Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12

z3: w3 = m*(Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc) = 1/12 z7: w7 = m*Pa ∧ ¬Pb Pc) = 1/12

z4: w4 = m*(Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12 z8: w8 = m*Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/4

Let us now compute the values of the confirmation function c*.

c*(the 3rd individual is P, 2 of the first 2 individuals are P) =

= m*(the 3rd individual is P, the first 2 individuals are P)/m*(the first 2 individuals are P)

= m*(the first 3 individuals are P)/m*(the first 2 individuals are P)

= m*(Pa Pb Pc)/m*(Pa Pb)

= (1/4)/(1/4 + 1/12)

= 3/4

> 1/2 = m*(Pc) = c* (the 3rd individual is P)

The general formula is (Carnap 1950/1962, 568)

c*(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P)

= (k + ϖ)/(n + κ)

= (k + (ϖ/κ)•κ)/(n + κ),

where ϖ is the “logical width” of the predicate “P” (Carnap 1950/1962, 127), that is, the number of maximally consistent properties or Q-predicates whose disjunction is logically equivalent to “P” (ϖ = 1 in our example: “P”). κ = 2π is the total number of Q-predicates (κ = 21 = 2 in our example: “P” and “¬P”) with π being the number of primitive predicates (π = 1 in our example: “P”). This formula is dependent on the logical factor ϖ/κ of the “relative width” of the predicate “P,” and the empirical factor k/n of the relative frequency of Ps.

Later on, Carnap (1952) generalizes this to a whole continuum of confirmation functions Cλ where the parameter λ is inversely proportional to the impact of evidence. λ specifies how the confirmation function Cλ weighs between the logical factor ϖ/κ and the empirical factor k/n. For λ = ∞, Cλ is independent of the empirical factor k/n: Cλ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = ϖ/κ (Carnap 1952, §13). For λ = 0, Cλ is independent of the logical factor ϖ/κ: Cλ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = k/n and thus coincides with what is known as the straight rule (Carnap 1952, §14). c*is the special case with λ = κ (Carnap 1952, §15). The general formula is (Carnap 1952, §9)

Cλ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = (k + λ/κ)/(n + λ).

In his (1963) Carnap slightly modifies the set up and considers families of monadic predicates {“P1,” …, “Pp“} like the family of color predicates {“red,” “green,” …, “blue”}. For a given family {“P1,” …, “Pp“} and each individual constant “a” there is exactly one predicate “Pj” such that Pja. Families thus generalize {“P,” “¬P“} and correspond to random variables. Given his axioms (including A15), Carnap (1963, 976) can show that for each family {“P1,” …, “Pp“}, p ≥ 2,

Cλ(the n + 1st individual is Pj, k of the first n individuals are Pj) = (k + λ/p)/(n + λ).

One of the peculiar features of Carnap’s systems is that universal generalizations get degree of confirmation (alias conditional probability) 0. Hintikka (1966) generalizes Carnap’s project in this respect. For a neo-Carnapian approach see Maher (2004a).

Of more interest to us is Carnap’s discussion of “the controversial problem of the justification of induction” (1963, 978, emphasis in the original). For Carnap, the justification of induction boils down to justifying the axioms specifying a set of confirmation functions. The “reasons are based upon our intuitive judgments concerning inductive validity”. Therefore “[i]t is impossible to give a purely deductive justification of induction,” and these “reasons are a priori” (Carnap 1963, 978). So according to Carnap, induction is justified by appeals to intuition about inductive validity. We will see below that Goodman, who is otherwise very skeptical about the prospects of Carnap’s project, shares this view of the justification of induction. The view also seems to be widely accepted among current Bayesian confirmation theorists and their desideratum/explicatum approach (see Fitelson 2001 for an example). [According to Carnap (1962), an explication is “the transformation of an inexact, prescientific concept, the explicandum, into a new exact concept, the explicatum.” (Carnap 1962, 3) The desideratum/explicatum approach consists in stating various “intuitively plausible desiderata” the explicatum is supposed to satisfy. Proposals for explicata that do not satisfy these desiderata are rejected. This appeal to intuitions is fine as long as we are engaging in conceptual analysis. However, contemporary confirmation theorists also sell their accounts as normative theories. Normative theories are not justified by appeal to intuitions. They are justified relative to a goal by showing that the norms in question further the goal at issue. See section 7.]

First, however, we will have a look at what Carnap has to say about Hempel’s conditions of adequacy.

c. Absolute and Incremental Confirmation

As we saw in the preceding section, one of Carnap’s goals was to define a quantitative notion of confirmation, explicated by a confirmation function in the manner indicated above. It is important to note that this quantitative concept of confirmation is a relation between two propositions H and E (three, if we include the background information B), a number r, and a confirmation function c. In chapters VI and VII of his (1950/1962) Carnap discusses comparative and qualitative concepts of confirmation. The explicans for qualitative confirmation he offers is that of positive probabilistic relevance in the sense of some logical probability m. That is, E qualitatively confirms H in the sense of some logical measure m just in case E is positively relevant to H in the sense of m, that is,

m(HE) > m(H)•m(E).

If both m(H) and m(E) are positive—which is the case whenever both H and E are not logically false, because Carnap assumes m to be regular—this is equivalently expressed by the following inequality:

c(H, E) > c(H, τ) = m(H)

So provided both H and E have positive probability, E confirms H if and only if E raises the conditional probability (degree of confirmation in the sense of c) of H. Let us call this concept incremental confirmation. Again, note that qualitative confirmation is a relation between two propositions H and E, and a conditional probability or confirmation function c. Incremental confirmation, or positive probabilistic relevance, is a qualitative notion. It says whether E raises the conditional probability (degree of confirmation in the sense of c) of H. Its natural quantitative counterpart measures how much E raises the conditional probability of H. This measure may take several forms which will be discussed below.

Incremental confirmation is different from the concept of absolute confirmation on which it is based. The quantitative explication of absolute confirmation is given by one of Carnap’s confirmation functions c. The qualitative counterpart is to say that E absolutely confirms H in the sense of c if and only if the degree of absolute confirmation of H by E is sufficiently high, c(H, E) > r. So Carnap, who offers degree of absolute confirmation c(H, E) as explication for the quantitative notion of confirmation of H by E, and who offers incremental confirmation or positive probabilistic relevance between E and H as explication of the qualitative notion of confirmation, is, to say the least, not fully consistent in his terminology. He switches between absolute confirmation (for the quantitative notion) and incremental confirmation (for the qualitative notion). This is particularly peculiar, because Carnap (1950/1962, §87) is the locus classicus for the discussion of Hempel’s conditions of adequacy mentioned in section 2b.

d. Carnap’s Analysis of Hempel’s Conditions

In analyzing the special consequence condition, Carnap argues that

Hempel has in mind as explicandum the following relation: “the degree of confirmation of H by E is greater than r, where r is a fixed value, perhaps 0 or 1/2 (Carnap 1962, 475; notation adapted);

that is, the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation. Similarly when discussing the special consistency condition:

Hempel regards it as a great advantage of any explicatum satisfying [a more general form of the special consistency condition 3] “that it sets a limit, so to speak, to the strength of the hypotheses which can be confirmed by given evidence” … This argument does not seem to have any plausibility for our explicandum, (Carnap 1962, 477; emphasis in original)

which is the qualitative concept of incremental confirmation,

[b]ut it is plausible for the second explicandum mentioned earlier: the degree of [absolute] confirmation exceeding a fixed value r. Therefore we may perhaps assume that Hempel’s acceptance of [a more general form of 3] is due again to an inadvertent shift to the second explicandum. (Carnap 1962, 477-478)

Carnap’s analysis can be summarized as follows. In presenting his first three conditions of adequacy, Hempel was mixing up two distinct concepts of confirmation, two distinct explicanda in Carnap’s terminology, namely,

(i) the qualitative concept of incremental confirmation (positive probabilistic relevance) according to which E confirms H if and only if E (has non-zero probability and) increases the degree of absolute confirmation (conditional probability) of H, and

(ii) the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation according to which E confirms H if and only if the degree of absolute confirmation (conditional probability) of H by E is greater than some value r.

Hempel’s second and third condition, 2 and 3, respectively, hold true for the second explicandum (for r ≥ 1/2), but they do not hold true for the first explicandum. On the other hand, Hempel’s first condition holds true for the first explicandum, but it does so only in a qualified form (Carnap 1950/1962, 473)—namely only if E is not assigned probability 0, and H is not already assigned probability 1.

This, however, means that, according to Carnap’s analysis, Hempel first had in mind the explicandum of incremental confirmation for the entailment condition. Then he had in mind the explicandum of absolute confirmation for the special consequence and the special consistency conditions 2 and 3, respectively. And then, when Hempel presented the converse consequence condition, he got completely confused and had in mind still another explicandum or concept of confirmation (neither the first nor the second explicandum satisfies the converse consequence condition). This is not a very charitable analysis. It is not a good one either, because the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation, which Hempel is said to have had in mind for 2 and 3, also satisfies 1—and it does so without the second qualification that H be assigned a probability smaller than 1. So there is no need to accuse Hempel of mixing up two concepts of confirmation. Indeed, the analysis is bad, because Carnap’s reading of Hempel also leaves open the question of what the third explicandum for the converse consequence condition might have been. For a different analysis of Hempel’s conditions and a corresponding logic of confirmation see Huber (2007a).

5. The New Riddle of Induction and the Demise of the Syntactic Approach

According to Goodman (1983, ch. III), the problem of justifying induction boils down to defining valid inductive rules, and thus to a definition of confirmation. The reason is that an inductive inference is justified by conformity to an inductive rule, and inductive rules are justified by their conformity to accepted inductive practices. One does not have to follow Goodman in this respect, however, in order to appreciate his insight that whether a hypothesis is confirmed by a piece of evidence depends on features other than their syntactical form.

In his (1946) he asks us to suppose a marble has been drawn from a certain bowl on each of the ninety-nine days up to and including VE day, and that each marble drawn was red. Our evidence can be described by the conjunction “Marble 1 is red and … and marble 99 is red,” in symbols: Ra1∧ …∧ Ra99. Whatever the details of our theory of confirmation, this evidence will confirm the hypothesis “Marble 100 is red,” R100. Now consider the predicate S = “is drawn by VE day and is red, or is drawn after VE day and is not red.” In terms of S rather than R our evidence is described by the conjunction “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and is red or it is drawn after VE day and is not red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and is red or it is drawn after VE day and is not red,” Sa1∧ …∧ Sa99. If our theory of confirmation relies solely on syntactical features of the evidence and the hypothesis, our evidence will confirm the conclusion “Marble 100 is drawn by VE and is red, or it is drawn after VE day and is not red,” S100. But we know that the next marble will be drawn after VE day. Given this, S100 is logically equivalent to the negation of R100. So one and the same piece of evidence can be used to confirm a hypothesis and its negation, which is certainly absurd.

One might object to this example that the two formulations do not describe one and the same piece of evidence after all. The first formulation in terms of R should be the conjunction “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and is red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and is red,” (Da1Ra1)∧ …∧ (Da99Ra99). The second formulation in terms of S should be “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and it is drawn by VE day and red or drawn after VE and not red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and it is drawn by VE day and red or drawn after VE day and not red,” (Da1Sa1)∧ …∧ (Da99Sa99). Now the two formulations really describe one and the same piece of evidence in the sense of being logically equivalent. But then the problem is whether any interesting statement can ever be confirmed. The syntactical form of the evidence now seems to confirm Da100Ra100, equivalently Da100Sa100. But we know that the next marble is drawn after VE day; that is, we know ¬Da100. That the future resembles the past in all respects is thus false. That it resembles the past in some respects is trivial. The new riddle of induction is the question in which respects the future resembles the past, and in which it does not.

It has been suggested that the puzzling character of Goodman’s example is due to its mentioning a particular point of time, namely, VE day. A related reaction has been that gerrymandered predicates, whether or not they involve a particular point of time, cannot be used in inductive inferences. But there are plenty of similar examples (Stalker 1994), and it is commonly agreed that Goodman has succeeded in showing that a purely syntactical definition of (degree of) confirmation won’t do. Goodman himself sought to solve his new riddle of induction by distinguishing between “projectible” predicates such as “red” and unprojectible predicates such as “is drawn by VE day and is red, or is drawn after VE day and is not red.” The projectibility of a predicate is in turn determined by its entrenchment in natural language. This comes very close to saying that the projectible predicates are the ones that we do in fact project (that is, use in inductive inferences). (Quine’s 1969 “natural kinds” are special cases of what can be described by projectible predicates.)

6. Bayesian Confirmation Theory

Bayesian confirmation theory is by far the most popular and elaborated theory of confirmation. It has its origins in Rudolf Carnap’s work on inductive logic (Carnap 1950/1962), but relieves itself from defining confirmation in terms of logical probability. More or less any subjective degree of belief function satisfying the Kolmogorov axioms is considered to be an admissible probability measure.

a. Subjective Probability and the Dutch Book Argument

In Bayesian confirmation theory, a probability measure on a field of propositions is usually interpreted as an agent’s degree of belief function. There is disagreement about how broad the class of admissible probability measures is to be construed. Some objective Bayesians such as the early Carnap insist that the class consist of a single logical probability measure, whereas subjective Bayesians admit any probability measure. Most Bayesians will be somewhere in the middle of this spectrum when it comes to the question which particular degree of belief functions it is reasonable to adopt in a particular situation. However, they will agree that from a purely logical point of view any (regular) probability measure is acceptable. The standard argument for this position is the Dutch Book Argument.

The Dutch Book Argument starts with the assumption that there is a link between subjective degrees of belief and betting ratios. It is further assumed that it is pragmatically defective to accept a series of bets which guarantees a sure loss, that is, a Dutch Book. By appealing to the Dutch Book Theorem that an agent’s betting ratios satisfy the probability axioms just in case they do not make the agent vulnerable to such a Dutch Book, it is inferred that it is epistemically defective to have degrees of belief that violate the probability axioms. The strength of this inference is, of course, dependent on the link between degrees of belief and betting ratios. If this link is identity—as it is when one defines degrees of belief as betting ratios—the distinction between pragmatic and epistemic defectiveness disappears, and the Dutch Book Argument is a deductively valid argument. But this comes at the cost of rendering the link between degrees of belief and betting ratios implausible. If the link is weaker than identity—as it is when degrees of belief are only measured by betting ratios—the Dutch Book Argument is not deductively valid anymore, but it has more plausible assumptions.

The pragmatic nature of the Dutch Book Argument has led to so called depragmatized versions. A depragmatized Dutch Book Argument starts with a link between degrees of belief and fair betting ratios, and it assumes that it is epistemically defective to consider a series of bets that guarantees a sure loss as fair. Using the depragmatized Dutch Book Theorem that an agent’s fair betting ratios obey the probability calculus if and only if the agent never considers a Dutch Book as fair, it is then inferred that it is epistemically defective to have degrees of belief that do not obey the probability calculus. The thesis that an agent’s degree of belief function should obey the probability calculus is called probabilism. For more on the Dutch Book Argument see Hájek (2005) and Vineberg (2005). For a different justification of probabilism in terms of the accuracy of degrees of belief see Joyce (1998).

b. Confirmation Measures

Let A be a field of propositions over some set of possibilities W, let H, E, B be propositions from A, and let Pr be a probability measure on A. We already know that H is incrementally confirmed by E relative to B in the sense of Pr if and only if Pr(HE|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B), and that this is a relation between three propositions and a probability space whose field contains the propositions. The central notion in Bayesian confirmation theory is that of a confirmation measure. A real valued function c: P → ℜ from the set P of all probability spaces <W, A, Pr> into the reals ℜ is a confirmation measure if and only if for every probability space <W, A, Pr> and all H, E, BA:

c(H, E, B) > 0 ↔ Pr(HE|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

c(H, E, B) = 0 ↔ Pr(HE|B) = Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

c(H, E, B) < 0 ↔ Pr(HE|B) < Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

The six most popular confirmation measures are (what I now call) the Carnap measure c (Carnap 1962), the distance measure d (Earman 1992), the log-likelihood or Good-Fitelson measure l (Fitelson 1999 and Good 1983), the log-ratio or Milne measure r (Milne 1996), the Joyce-Christensen measure s (Christensen 1999, Joyce 1999, ch. 6), and the relative distance measure z (Crupi & Tentori & Gonzalez 2007).

c(H, E, B) = Pr(HE|B) – Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

d(H, E, B) = Pr(H|EB) – Pr(H|B)

l(H, E, B) = log [Pr(E|HB)/Pr(E|-HB)]

r(H, E, B) = log [Pr(H|EB)/Pr(H|B)]

s(H, E, B) = Pr(H|EB) – Pr(H|-EB)

z(H, E, B) = [Pr(H|EB) – Pr(H|B)]/Pr(-H|B) if Pr(H|EB) ≥Pr(H|B)

= [Pr(H|EB) – Pr(H|B)]/Pr(H|B) if Pr(H|EB) < Pr(H|B)

(Mathematically speaking, there are uncountably many confirmation measures.) For an overview article, see Eells (2005). Book length expositions are Earman (1992) and Howson & Urbach (1989/2005).

c. Some Success Stories

Bayesian confirmation theory captures the insights of Popper’s falsificationism and hypothetico-deductive confirmation. Suppose evidence E falsifies hypothesis H relative to background information B in the sense that BHE = ∅. Then Pr(EH|B) = 0, and so Pr(EH|B) = 0 < Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B), provided both Pr(H|B) and Pr(E|B) are positive. So as long as H is not already known to be false (in the sense of having probability 0 conditional on B) and E is a possible outcome (one with positive probability conditional on B), falsifying E incrementally disconfirms H relative to B in the sense of Pr.

Remember, E HD-confirms H relative to B if and only if the conjunction of H and B logically implies E (in some suitable way). In this case Pr(EH|B) = Pr(H|B), provided Pr(B) > 0. Hence as long as Pr(E|B) < 1, we have

Pr(EH|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B),

which means that E incrementally confirms H relative to B in the sense of Pr (Kuipers 2000).

If the conjunction of H and B logically implies E, but E is already known to be true in the sense of having probability 1 conditional on B, E does not incrementally confirm H relative to B in the sense of Pr. In fact, no E which receives probability 1 conditional on B can incrementally confirm any H whatsoever. This is the so called problem of old evidence (Glymour 1980). It is a special case of a more general phenomenon. The following is true for many confirmation measures (d, l, and r, but not s). If H is positively relevant to E given B, the degree to which E incrementally confirms H relative to B is greater, the smaller the probability of E given B. Similarly, if H is negatively relevant for E given B, the degree to which E disconfirms H relative to B is greater, the smaller the probability of E given B (Huber 2005a). If Pr(E|B) = 1 we have the problem of old evidence. If Pr(E|B) = 0 we have the above mentioned problem that E cannot disconfirm hypotheses it falsifies.

Some people simply deny that the problem of old evidence is a problem. Bayesian confirmation theory, it is said, does not explicate whether and how much E confirms H relative to B. It explicates whether E is additional evidence for H relative to B, and how much additional confirmation E provides for H relative to B. If E already has probability 1 conditional on B, it is part of the background knowledge, and so does not provide any additional evidence for H. More generally, the more we already believe in E, the less additional (dis)confirmation this provides for positively (negatively) relevant H. This reply does not work in case E is a falsifier of H with probability 0 conditional on B, for in this case Pr(H|EB) is not defined. It also does not agree with the fact that the problem of old evidence is taken seriously in the literature on Bayesian confirmation theory (Earman 1992, ch. 5). An alternative view (Joyce 1999, ch. 6) sees several different, but equally legitimate, concepts of confirmation at work. The intuition behind one concept is the reason for the implausibility of the explication of another.

In contrast to hypothetico-deductivism, Bayesian confirmation theory has no problem with assigning degrees of incremental confirmation to statistical hypotheses. Such alternative statistical hypotheses H1, …Hn, … are taken to specify the probability of an outcome E. The probabilities Pr(E|H1), …Pr(E|Hn), … are called the likelihoods of the hypotheses Hi. Together with their prior probabilities Pr(Hi) the likelihoods determine the posterior probabilities of the Hi via Bayes’s Theorem:

Pr(Hi|E) = Pr(E|Hi)•Pr(Hi)/[ΣjPr(E|Hj)•Pr(Hj) + Pr(E|H)•Pr(H)]

The so called “catchall” hypothesis H is the negation of the disjunction or union of all the alternative hypotheses Hi, and so it is equivalent to -(H1∪…∪Hn∪…). It is important to note the implicit use of something like the principal principle (Lewis 1980) in such an application of Bayes’ Theorem. The probability measure Pr figuring in the above equation is an agent’s degree of belief function. The statistical hypotheses Hi specify the objective chance of the outcome E as Chi(E). Without a principle linking objective chances to subjective degrees of belief, nothing guarantees that the agent’s conditional degree of belief in E given Hi, Pr(E|Hi), is equal to the chance of E as specified by Hi, Chi(E). The principal principle says that an agent’s conditional degree of belief in a proposition A given the information that the chance of A is equal to r (and no further inadmissible information) should be r, Pr(A|Ch(A) = r) = r. For more on the principal principle see Hall (1994), Lewis (1994), Thau (1994), as well as Briggs (2009a). Spohn (2010) shows that the principal principle is a special case of the reflection principle (van Fraassen 1984; 1995, Briggs 2009b). The latter principle says that an agent’s current conditional degree of belief in A given that her future degree of belief in A equals r should be r,

Prnow(A|Prlater(A) = r) = r provided Prnow(Prlater(A)=r) > 0.

Bayesian confirmation theory can also handle the ravens paradox. As we have seen, Hempel thought that “a is neither black nor a raven” confirms “All ravens are black” relative to no or tautological background information. He attributed the unintuitive character of this claim to a conflation of it and the claim that “a is neither black nor a raven” confirms “All ravens are black” relative to our actual background knowledge A—and the fact that A contains the information that there are more non-black objects than ravens. The latter information is reflected in our degree of belief function Pr by the inequality

PrBa|A) > Pr(Ra|A).

If we further assume that the probabilities of finding a non-black object as well as finding a raven are independent of whether or not all ravens are black,

PrBa|∀x(Rx Bx)∧A) = PrBa|A),

Pr(Ra|∀x(Rx Bx)∧A) = Pr(Ra|A),

we can infer (when we assume all probabilities to be defined) that

Pr(∀x(Rx Bx)|RaBaA) > Pr(∀x(Rx Bx)|¬Ra∧¬BaA) >
Pr
(∀x(Rx Bx)|A).

So Hempel’s intuitions are vindicated by Bayesian confirmation theory to the extent that the above independence assumptions are plausible (or there are weaker assumptions entailing a similar result), and to the extent that he also took non-black non-ravens to confirm the ravens hypothesis relative to our actual background knowledge. For more, see Vranas (2004).

Let us finally consider the problem of irrelevant conjunction in Bayesian confirmation theory. HD-confirmation satisfies the converse consequence condition, and so has the undesirable feature that E confirms HH’ relative to B whenever E confirms H relative to B, for any H’ whatsoever. This is not true for incremental confirmation. Even if Pr(EH|B) > Pr(E|B)•Pr(H|B), it need not be the case that Pr(EHH’|B) > Pr(E|B)•Pr(HH’|B). However, the following special case is also true for incremental confirmation.

If HB logically implies E, then E incrementally confirms HH’ relative to B, for any H’ whatsoever (whenever the relevant probabilities are defined).

In the spirit of the last paragraph, one can, however, show that HH’ is less confirmed by E relative to B than H alone (in the sense of the distance measure d and the Good-Fitelson measure l) if H’ is an irrelevant conjunct to H given B with respect to E in the sense that

Pr(E|HH’B) = Pr(E|HB)

(Hawthorne & Fitelson 2004). If HB logically implies E, then every H’ such that Pr(HH’B) > 0 is irrelevant in this sense. For more see Fitelson (2002), Hawthorne & Fitelson (2004), Maher (2004b).

7. Taking Stock

Let us grant that Bayesian confirmation theory adequately explicates the concept of confirmation. If so, then this is the concept scientists use when they say that the anomalous perihelion of Mercury confirms the general theory of relativity. It is also the concept more ordinary epistemic agents use when they say that, relative to what they have experienced so far, the dark clouds on the sky are evidence that it will rain soon. The question remains what happened to Hume’s problem of the justification of induction. We know—by definition—that the conclusion of an inductively strong argument is well-confirmed by its premises. But does that also justify our acceptance of that conclusion? Don’t we first have to justify our definition of confirmation before we can use it to justify our inductive inferences?

It seems we would have to, but, as Hume argued, such a justification of induction is not possible. All we could hope for is an adequate description of our inductive practices. As we have seen, Goodman took the task of adequately describing induction as being tantamount to its justification (Goodman 1983, ch. III, ascribes a similar view to Hume, which is somehow peculiar, because Hume argued that a justification of induction is impossible). In doing so he appealed to deductive logic, which he claimed to be justified by its conformity to accepted practices of deductive reasoning. But that is not so. Deductive logic is not justified because it adequately describes our practices of deductive reasoning—it doesn’t. The rules of deductive logic are justified relative to the goal of truth preservation in all possible worlds. The reasons are that (i) in going from the premises of a deductively valid argument to its conclusion, truth is preserved in all possible worlds (this is known as soundness); and that (ii) any argument with that property is a deductively valid argument (this is known as completeness). Similarly for the rules of nonmonotonic logic, which are justified relative to the goal of truth preservation in all “normal” worlds (for normality see e.g. Koons 2005). The reason is that all and only nonmonotonically valid inferences are such that truth is preserved in all normal worlds when one jumps from the premises to the conclusion (Kraus & Lehmann & Magidor 1990, for a survey see Makinson 1994). More generally, the justification of a canon of normative principles—such as the rules of deductive logic, the rules of nonmonotonic logic, or the rules of inductive logic—are only justified relative to a certain goal when one can show that adhering to these normative principles in some sense furthers the goal in question.

Much like Goodman, Carnap sought to justify the principles of his inductive logic by appeals to intuition (cf. the quote in section 4b). Contemporary Bayesian confirmation theorists with their desideratum/explicatum approach follow Carnap and Goodman at least insofar as they apparently do not see the need for justifying their accounts of confirmation by more than appeals to intuition. These are supposed to show that their definitions of confirmation are adequate. But the alleged impossibility of justifying induction does not entail that its adequate description or explication in form of a particular theory of confirmation is sufficient to justify inductive inferences based on that theory. Moreover, as noted by Reichenbach (1938; 1940), a justification of induction is not impossible after all. Hume was right in claiming that there is no deductively valid argument with knowable premises and the conclusion that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions. But this is not the only conclusion that would justify induction. Reichenbach was mainly interested in the limiting relative frequencies of particular types of events in various sequences of events. He could show that a particular inductive rule—the straight rule that conjectures that the limiting relative frequency is equal to the observed relative frequency—will converge to the true limiting relative frequency, if any inductive rule does. However, the straight rule is not the only rule with this property. Therefore its justification relative to the goal of converging to limiting relative frequencies is at least incomplete. If we want to keep the analogy to deductive logic, we can put things as follows: Reichenbach was able to establish the soundness, but not the completeness, of his inductive logic (that is, the straight rule) with respect to the goal of converging to the true limiting relative frequency. (Reichenbach himself provides an example that proves the incompleteness of the straight rule with respect to this goal.)

While soundness in this sense is not sufficient for a justification of the straight rule, such results provide more reasons than appeals to intuition. They are necessary conditions for the justification of a normative rule of inference relative to a particular goal of inquiry. A similar view about the justification of induction is held by formal learning theory. Here one considers the objective reliability with which a particular method (such as the straight rule or a particular confirmation measure) finds out the correct answer to a given question. The use of a method to answer a question is only justified when the method reliably answers the question, if any method does. As different questions differ in their complexity, there are different senses of reliability. A method may correctly answer a question after finitely many steps and with a sign that the question is answered correctly—as when we answer the question whether the first observed raven is black by saying “yes” if it is, and “no” otherwise. Or it may answer the question after finitely many steps and with a sign that it has done so when the answer is “yes,” but not when the answer is “no”—as when we answer the question whether there exists a black raven by saying “yes” when we first observe a black raven, and by saying “no” otherwise. Or it may stabilize to the correct answer in the sense that the method conjectures the right answer after finitely many steps and continues to do so forever without necessarily giving a sign that it has arrived at the correct answer—as when we answer the question whether the limiting relative frequency of black ravens among all ravens is greater than .5 by saying “yes” as long as the observed relative frequency is greater than .5, and by saying “no” otherwise (under the assumption that this limit exists). And so on. This provides a classification of all problems in terms of their complexity. The use of a particular method for answering a question of a certain complexity is only justified if the method reliably answers the question in the sense of reliability determined by the complexity of the question. A discussion of Bayesian confirmation theory from the point of view of formal learning theory can be found in Kelly & Glymour (2004). Schulte (2002) gives an introduction to the main philosophical ideas of formal learning theory. A technically advanced book length exposition is Kelly (1996). The general idea is the same as before. A rule is justified relative to a certain goal to the extent that the rule furthers achieving the goal.

So can we justify particular inductive rules in the form of confirmation measures along these lines? We had better, for otherwise there might be inductive rules that would reliably lead us to the correct answer about a question where our inductive rules won’t (cf. Putnam 1963a; see also his 1963b). Before answering this question, let us first be clear which goal confirmation is supposed to further. In other words, why should we accept well-confirmed hypotheses rather than any other hypotheses? A natural answer is that science and our more ordinary epistemic enterprises aim at true hypotheses. The justification for confirmation would then be that we should accept well-confirmed hypotheses, because we are in some sense guaranteed to arrive at true hypotheses if (and only if) we stick to well-confirmed hypotheses. Something along these lines is true for absolute confirmation according to which degree of confirmation is equal to probability conditional on the data. More precisely, the Gaifman and Snir convergence theorem (Gaifman & Snir 1982) says that for almost every world or model w for the underlying language—that is, all worlds w except, possibly, for those in a set of measure 0 (in the sense of the measure Pr* on the σ-field A from section 4a)—the probability of a hypothesis conditional on the first n data sentences from w converges to its truth value in w (1 for true, 0 for false). It is assumed here that the set of all data sentences separates the set of all worlds (in the sense that for any two distinct worlds there is a data sentence which is true in the one and false in the other world). If we accept a hypothesis as true as soon as its probability is greater than .5 (or any other positive threshold value < 1), and reject it as false otherwise, we are guaranteed to almost surely arrive at true hypotheses after finitely many steps. That does not mean that no other method can do equally well. But it is more than to simply appeal to our intuitions, and a necessary condition for the justification of absolute confirmation relative to the goal of truth. See also Earman (1992, ch. 9) and Juhl (1997).

A more limited result is true for incremental confirmation. Based on the Gaifman and Snir convergence theorem one can show for every confirmation measure c and almost all worlds w that there is an n such that for all later m: the conjunction of the first m data sentences confirms hypotheses that are true in w to a non-negative degree, and it confirms hypotheses that are false in w to a non-positive degree (the set of all data sentences is again assumed to separate the set of all worlds). Even if this more limited result were a satisfying justification for the claim that incremental confirmation furthers the goal of truth, the question remains why one has to go to incremental confirmation in order to arrive at true theories. It also remains unclear what degrees of incremental confirmation are supposed to indicate, for it is completely irrelevant for the above result whether a positive degree of confirmation is high or low—all that matters is that it is positive. This is in contrast to absolute confirmation. There a high number represents a high probability—that is, a high probability of being true—which almost surely converges to the truth value itself. To make these vague remarks more vivid, let us consider an example.

Suppose I know I get a bottle of wine for my birthday, and I am curious as to whether it is a bottle or red wine, A, white wine, B, or rosé, C. It is common knowledge that I like red wine, and so my initial degree of belief function Pr is such that

Pr(A) = .9, Pr(B) = Pr(C) = .05, Pr(AB) = Pr(AC) = Pr(BC) = 0,

Pr(AB) = Pr(AC) = .95, Pr(BC) = .1, Pr(ABC) = 1,

Pr(AG) = .4, Pr(BG) = .03, Pr(CG) = .03, Pr(G) = .46,

where G is the proposition that I will get a bottle of Austrian wine. [More precisely, the probability space is <L, Pr> with L the propositional language over the set of propositional variables {A, B, C, G} and Pr such that Pr(AG) = .4, Pr(BG) = .03, Pr(CG) = .03, Pr(A∧¬G) = .5, Pr(B∧¬G) = .02, Pr(C∧¬G) = .02, Pr(AB) = Pr(AC) = Pr(BC) = PrA∧¬B∧¬C)= 0.] This is a fairly reasonable degree of belief function. Most wine from Austria is white wine or rosé, although there are some Austrian red wines as well. Furthermore I tend to use the principal principle whenever I can (assuming a close connection between objective chances and relative frequencies). Now suppose I learn that I will get a bottle of Austrian wine, G. My new degrees of belief are

Pr(A|G) = 40/46, Pr(B|G) = 3/46, Pr(C|G) = 3/46,

Pr(AB|G) = Pr(AC|G) = 43/46, Pr(BC|G) = 6/46, Pr(ABC|G) = 1.

G incrementally confirms B, C, BC, AC, BC, it neither incrementally confirms nor incrementally disconfirms ABC, and it incrementally disconfirms A.

However, my degree of belief in A is still more than thirteen times my degree of belief in B and my degree of belief in C. And whether I have to bet on these propositions or whether I am just curious what bottle of wine I will get, all I care about after having received evidence G will be my new degrees of belief in the various answers—and my utilities, including my desire to answer the question. I will be willing to bet on A at less favorable odds than on either B or C or even their disjunction; and should I buy new wine glasses for the occasion, I would buy red wine glasses. In this situation, incremental confirmation and degrees of incremental confirmation are at best misleading.

[What is important is a way of updating my old degree of belief function by the incoming evidence. The above example assumes evidence to come in the form of a proposition that I become certain of. In this case, probabilism says I should update my degree of belief function by Strict Conditionalization (see Vineberg 2000):

If Pr is your subjective probability at time t, and between t and t’ you learn E and no logically stronger proposition in the sense that your new degree of belief in E is 1, then your new subjective probability at time t’ should be Pr(•|E).

As Jeffrey (1983) observes, we usually do not learn by becoming certain of a proposition. Evidence often merely changes our degrees of belief in various propositions. Jeffrey Conditionalization is a more general update rule than Strict Conditionalization:

If Pr is your subjective probability at time t, and between t and t’ your degrees of belief in the countable partition {E1, …, En, …} change from Pr(Ei) to p∈ [0,1] (with Pr(Ei) = pi for Pr(Ei) ∈ {0,1}), and your positive degrees of belief do not change on any superset thereof, then your new subjective probability at time t’ should be Pr*, where for all A, Pr*(A) = ΣiPr(A|Ei)•pi.

For evidential input of the above form, Jeffrey Conditionalization turns regular probability measures into regular probability measures, provided no contingent evidential proposition receives an extreme value p ∈ {0,1}. Radical probabilism (Jeffrey 2004) urges you not to assign such extreme values, and to have a regular initial degree of belief function—that is, whenever you can (but you can’t always). Field (1978) proposes an update rule for evidence of a different format.

This is also the place to mention different formal frameworks besides probability theory. For an overview, see Huber (2008a).]

More generally, degrees of belief are important to us, because together with our desires they determine which acts it is rational for us to take. The usual recommendation according to rational choice theory for choosing one’s acts is to maximize one’s expected utility (the mathematical representation of one’s desires), that is, the quantity

EU(a) = ΣsSu(a(s))•Pr(s).

Here S is an exclusive and exhaustive set of states, u is the agent’s utility function over the set of outcomes a(s) which are the results of an act a in a state s (acts are identified with functions from states s to outcomes), and Pr is the agent’s probability measure on a field over S (Savage 1972, Joyce 1999, Buchak 2014). From this decision-theoretic point of view all we need—besides our utilities—are our degrees of belief encoded in Pr. Degrees of confirmation encoding how much one proposition increases the probability of another are of no use here.

In the above example I only consider the propositions A, B, C, because they are sufficiently informative to answer my question. If truth were the only thing I am interested in, I would be happy with the tautological answer that I will get some bottle of wine, ABC. But I am not. The reason is that I want to know what is going on out there—not only in the sense of having true beliefs, but also in the sense of having informative beliefs. In terms of decision theory, my decisions do not only depend on my degrees of belief—they also depend on my utilities. This is the idea behind the plausibility-informativeness theory (Huber 2008b), according to which epistemic utilities reduce to informativeness values. If we take as our epistemic utilities in the above example the informativeness values of the various answers (with positive probability) to our question, we get

I(A) = I(B) = I(C) = 1, I(AB) = I(AC) ≈ 40/83, I(BC) = 60/83, I(ABC) = 0,

where the question “What bottle of wine will I get for my birthday?” is represented by the partition Q = {A, B, C} and the informativeness values of the various answers are calculated according to

I(A) = 1 – [1 – ΣiPr*(Xi|A)2]/[1 – ΣiPr*(Xi)2],

a measure proposed by Hilpinen (1970). Contrary to what Hilpinen (1970, 112) claims, I(A) does not increase with the logical strength of A. The probability Pr* is the posterior degree of belief function from our example, Pr(•|G). If we insert these values into the expected utility formula,

EU(a) = Σs∈Su(a(s))•Pr*(s) = ΣX∈Qu(a(X))•Pr*(X) = ΣX∈QI(X)•Pr*(X),

we get the result that the act of accepting A as answer to our question maximizes our expected epistemic utility.

Not all is lost, however. The distance measure d turns out to measure the expected utility of accepting H when utility is identified with informativeness measured according to a measure proposed by Carnap & Bar-Hillel (1953) (one can think of this measure as measuring how much an answer informs about the most difficult question, namely, which world is the actual one?). Similarly, the Joyce-Christensen measure s turns out to measure the expected utility of accepting H when utility is identified with informativeness about the data measured according to a proposal by Hempel & Oppenheim (1948). So far, this is only interesting. It gets important by noting that d and s can also be justified relative to the goal of informative truth—and not just by appealing to our intuitions about maximizing expected utility. When based on a regular probability, there almost surely is an n such that for all later m: relative to the conjunction of the first m data sentences, contingently true hypotheses get a positive value and contingently false hypotheses get a negative value. Moreover, within the true hypotheses, logically stronger hypotheses get a higher value than logically weaker hypotheses. The logically strongest true hypothesis (the complete true theory about the world w) gets the highest value, followed by all logically weaker true hypotheses all the way down to the logically weakest true hypothesis, the tautology, which is sent to 0. Similarly within the false hypotheses: the logically strongest false hypothesis, the contradiction, is sent to 0, followed by all logically weaker false hypotheses all the way down to the logically weakest false hypothesis (the negation of the complete theory about w). As informativeness increases with logical strength, we can put this as follows (assuming that the underlying probability measure is regular): d and s do not only distinguish between true and false theories, as do all confirmation measures (as well as all conditional probabilities). They additionally distinguish between informative and uninformative true theories, as well as between informative and uninformative false theories. In this sense, they reveal the following structure of almost every world w [w(p) = w(q) = 1 in the toy example]:

informative and contingently true in w
pq
> 0 contingently true in w
p, q, pq
uninformative and contingently true in w
p∨q, ¬pq, p∨¬q
= 0 logically determined
p∨¬p, p∧¬p
informative and contingently false in w
¬p∧¬q, p∧¬q, ¬pq
< 0 contingently false in w
¬p, ¬q, p↔¬q
uninformative and contingently false in w
¬p∨¬q

This result is also true for the Carnap measure c, but it does not extend to all confirmation measures. It is false for the Milne measure r, which does not distinguish between informative and uninformative false theories. And it is false for the Good-Fitelson measure l, which distinguishes neither between informative and uninformative true theories nor between informative and uninformative false theories. For more see Huber (2005b).

The reason c, d, and s have this property of distinguishing between informative and uninformative truth and falsehood is that they are probabilistic assessment functions in the sense of the plausibility-informativeness theory (Huber 2008b)—and the above result is true for all probabilistic assessment functions (not only those that can be expressed as expected utilities). The plausibility-informativeness theory agrees with traditional philosophy that truth is an epistemic goal. Its distinguishing thesis is that there is a second epistemic goal besides truth, namely, informativeness, which has to be taken into account when we evaluate hypotheses. Like confirmation theory, the plausibility-informativeness theory assigns numbers to hypotheses in the light of evidence. But unlike confirmation theory, it does not appeal to intuitions when it comes to the question why one is justified in accepting hypotheses with high assessment values. The plausibility-informativeness theory answers this question by showing that accepting hypotheses according to the recommendation of an assessment function almost surely leads one to (the most) informative (among all) true hypotheses.

It is idle to speculate what Hume would have said to all this. Suffice it to note that his problem would not have gotten off the ground without our desire for informativeness.

8. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Franz Huber
Email: franz@caltech.edu
California Institute of Technology
U. S. A.

Guo Xiang (c. 252—312 C.E.)

Guo Xiang (also known as Kuo Hsiang and Zixuan) is the author of the most important commentary on the classic Daoist text Zhuangzi (Chuang-tzu). He is responsible for the current arrangement of thirty-three chapters divided into inner, outer and miscellaneous sections. His commentary represents a substantial philosophical achievement that has been compared to the Zhuangzi itself. Ostensibly the purpose of a commentary should be to elucidate the ideas in the original text. However, Guo’s Zhuangzi commentary adds many original ideas. It is possible to delve deeper into their meaning by examining the text on which he is commenting as if it were a commentary on the work of Guo. The fact that Guo chose to present his philosophy this way—within the framework of this Daoist classic—has served as a blueprint for the manner in which Confucians, Daoists and, increasingly from Guo’s time, Buddhists have engaged in constructive dialogue, building systems of thought which include the strengths of all three systems.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Work
  2. Central Concepts
    1. Lone/Self-Transformation and the Absence of a Creator
    2. Ziran, Action and Nonaction
    3. Comfort with One’s Role (an qi fen)
    4. The Sage
  3. Guo Xiang’s Influence on Chinese Thought
  4. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Very little is known about the life of Guo Xiang. He lived in a time of great political upheaval and yet his own political career was one of consistent and significant success. He maintained a high position within one of the six rebellious factions that contributed to the rapid demise of the Western Jin Dynasty (265-316 CE). This fact is interesting because unlike such contemporary figures as Ji Kang (223-262 CE) or Ruan Ji (210-263 CE), who both retired from what they saw as a corrupt governmental system, Guo remained to play what he regarded as the proper role of an engaged public dignitary.

Like the other great figure of the xuanxue (mysterious or profound learning) movement, Wang Bi (Wang Pi, 226-249 CE), Guo sought to synthesize the accepted Confucian morality within an ontological system that would encompass the insights expressed in the Zhuangzi and the Daodejing (Tao Te Ching). But while Wang Bi put the greatest emphasis on the unitary nature of reality, particularly in the concept of wu (nothingness), Guo emphasized individuality and interdependence. Guo’s position is not as diametrically opposed to Wang’s as is often assumed, Guo does not claim there is a dualist or objective reality to the world around us and he does maintain the use of dao as the unitary, nameless and formless basis of reality. This reality is expressed as a process Guo calls “self-transformation” or “lone transformation” (zihua or duha) in which all things are responsible for their own creation and for the set of relationships that exist between themselves and the rest of the world. Our self-transformation was and is at each moment conditioned by all the self-transformations coming before us and we in turn condition all the self-transformations that come after us. By shifting the focus onto those relationships, Guo arrives at a view of the transcendent sage that is radically different and innovative. While the traditional view of a Daoist sage was someone who removed himself from the mundane world, for Guo this notion is false and misleading. The social and political environments in which people relate to each other are no less natural than a forest or mountaintop and to a person who appreciates why she exists in the particular relationship to others in which she does, the proper course of action is not to run away, but to become involved. In other words, we must become engaged with the world around us, but not because of a continuous state of existence that we share with people and things around us, rather, it is because of a continuous act of creation that at its core makes us responsible for the world and its proper maintenance.

Ji Kang and Ruan Ji pursued the ideal of “overcoming orthodox teaching and following nature” (yue mingjiao er ren ziran). “Orthodox teaching” (mingjiao) includes the proper behavior being matched to the proper role, such as for a parent, a child, a ruler or a subject. Different xuanxue figures accepted these ideals to different extents, but nearly all held them in distinction to ziran, naturalness or spontaneity. Guo’s concept of ziran contained all governmental and social spheres, so it made no sense to try to set the realms of mingjiao and ziran in opposition to each other. For Guo, the roles required by Confucian propriety are not imposed upon a natural system that would otherwise be in chaos. They are, instead, the natural result of the system of spontaneous self-transformation and chaos is merely what results when one fails to recognize one’s proper role. Guo directs much of the Zhuangzi‘s advice about equalizing apparent contradiction in this direction.

There is some controversy over the true authorship of Guo’s commentary to the Zhuangzi. The earliest source, the Jin Shu (Standard History of the Jin Dynasty), accuses Guo of plagiarizing all but two chapters of the commentary from Xiang Xiu (d. 300 CE), writing a generation earlier. Current scholarship, while acknowledging that Guo made use of Xiang Xiu’s work and other earlier commentaries, still credits Guo as the principal author. The evidence for this recognition falls into three main areas. Firstly, the most innovative philosophical features in the commentary do not correspond with those in other works by Xiang Xiu. Secondly, in the early twentieth century, a postface to the commentary was discovered which details the work Guo carried out and finally, various linguistic analyses and references in other works suggest that Guo is the principal author.

2. Central Concepts

a. Lone/Self-transformation and the Absence of a Creator

Guo calls the process by which all things come into existence “lone transformation” (duhua) or “self-transformation” (zihua). The claim that all things share equally in creating the world does not deny that differences exist, but it does deny that these differences translate into differences of value. That one person may be less talented or intelligent than another does not affect the worth of that person, but rather helps determine the proper role for him to play

Given the importance of self-transformation in Guo’s philosophical system, he wished to deny any organizing principle. Even Wang Bi’s emphasis on wu (nothingness) came too close to occupying the place of an original cause. It was necessary for Guo to draw the line clearly, even if it meant contradicting the text on which he was commenting. In a note to a section of the Zhuangzi that leaves open the question of whether there is a creator, Guo writes:

The myriad things have myriad attributes, the adopting and discarding [of their attributes] is different, as if there was a true ruler making them do so. But if we search for evidence or a trace of this ruler, in the end we will not find it. We will then understand that things arise of themselves, and are not caused by something else. (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 2)

b. Ziran, Action and Nonaction

The natural, spontaneous state of affairs that results from the process of self-transformation is ziran. Ziran is a compound of two different terms zi, meaning “self” and ran, meaning “to be so,” and can be translated as “nature,” “the self-so,” or “things as they are.” While many other Daoist thinkers distinguish ziran from the mundane social world in which we live, for Guo they are identical. Even social hierarchy is the natural result of how things come to be as themselves. When we follow our natures, the result is peace and prosperity. When we oppose them, the result is chaos.

Thus, Guo seeks to provide a specific interpretation to the doctrine of nonaction (wuwei). He writes that “taking no action does not mean folding one’s arms and closing one’s mouth” (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 11). In chapter 3 of the Zhuangzi, we encounter the story of Cook Ding, who carves an ox, not by using his senses or dexterity, but by equating his idea of who he is with his situation and the task at hand. For Guo, if one has correctly perceived the way in which all things share in the creation of ziran, then correct action in the world will follow naturally.

Therefore, what Guo means by ziran is very different from what Western philosophers refer to as “the state of nature.” Ziran is the expression of a naturally peaceful and harmonious system, available to all who can recognize their place.

c. Comfort with One’s Role (an qi fen)

One key to the correct appreciation of one’s place in the world is Guo’s concept of fen, meaning “share” or “role.” Guo employs the idea of qi (ch’i), “vital energy” or “vital essence,” to explain the manner in which the dao imbues the world with life-giving force. One’s natural allotment of qi therefore determines one’s fen. The proper functioning of the world and the personal happiness of the people in it is maintained by the correct appreciation of one’s place. This is not to say Guo denies the possibility of growth and change, which are clear and necessary parts of nature, including social systems. In the same way that the body has hands, feet and head that play different roles according to their different endowments, so the world functions best when people act according to their proper fen. Thus, one’s fen is both the allotment of qi received from heaven and the role one must maintain within the system. Indeed, there is no difference between natural abilities and social obligations.

d. The Sage

For Guo, the Sage (shengren) is someone who directs his talent and understanding for the benefit of society. The phrase neisheng waiwang describes someone who is internally like a sage and outwardly acts as a ruler. In Guo’s view, the former necessitates the latter. In chapter one of the Zhuangzi, we read the story of the sage ruler Yao, who attempts to cede his throne to the recluse Xu You, but is rebuffed. In the story, it is clear that Xu You has a greater level of understanding than does Yao, but Guo’s commentary presents the matter differently:

Are we to insist that a man fold his arms and sit in silence in the middle of some mountain forest before we say that he is practicing nonaction? This is why the words of Laozi and Zhuangzi are rejected by responsible officials. This is why responsible officials insist on remaining in the realm of action without regret … egotistical people set themselves in opposition to things, while he who is in accord with things is not opposed to them … therefore he profoundly and deeply responds to things without any deliberate mind of his own and follows whatever comes into contact with him … he who is always with the people no matter what he does is the ruler of the world wherever he may be. (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 1)

It seems clear from these sentiments that in Guo’s view not only is Yao a better model for a ruler than Xu You, but also that Confucius is a better model for a sage than Zhuangzi.

3. Guo Xiang’s Influence on Chinese Thought

The Zhuangzi has long been held in high regard as one of the main pillars of Daoist philosophy, as well as one of the most accessible, entertaining and popular philosophical works of any genre. However the important contribution of Guo to the way in which we understand the Zhuangzi is less well known, particularly in its non-Chinese translations. He deserves credit not only for the external editing and arrangement of the text, but more importantly for developing a philosophical framework that allows for the continued dominance of accepted Confucian codes of proper behavior, yet still keeps open philosophical discussion of wider insights on the nature of reality. While the earlier work of Wang Bi may have eased the entry of Buddhism into the Chinese mainstream, it is within the framework provided by Guo that the three strands of Buddhism, Daoism and Confucianism have found a strategy for coexistence that has contributed to the success and growth of them all.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Allison, Robert E. Chuang-Tzu for Spiritual Transformation. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1990.
  • Aoki, Goro. “Kaku Sho Soshichu shisen” [Examining Guo Xiang’s Zhuangzi commentary]. Kyoto kyoiku gaku kiyo 55 (1979): 196-202.
  • Chan, Alan K.L. “Guo Xiang.” In The Encyclopedia of Chinese Philosophy, ed. Anthonio S. Cua, New York: Routledge, 2003, 280-284.
  • Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
    • A good selection of translated passages in addition to an excellent treatment of Guo Xiang’s thought and xuanxue in general.
  • Feng, Yu-lan (Feng Youlan) trans. Chuang Tzu: A New Selected Translation with an Exposition of the Philosophy of Kuo Hsiang, Shanghai: Commercial Press, 1933. (Reprint, New York: Gordon, 1975.)
  • Feng, Yu-lan (Feng Youlan). A History of Chinese Philsosophy, v. 2, trans. Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1953.
  • Fukunaga, Mitsuji. “Kako Sho no Soshi chu to Ko Shu no Shoshi chu” [Guo Xiang’s Zhuangzi commentary and Xiang Xiu’s Zhuangzi commentary]. Toho gakuho 36 (1964): 187-215.
    • This was some of the groundbreaking work on the Xiang Xiu controversy. Its findings are summarized in English by Livia Knaul’s article in The Journal of Chinese Religions.
  • Fukunaga, Mitsuji. “‘No-Mind’ in Chuang-tzu and Ch’an Buddhism.” Zinbun 12 (1969): 9-45.
  • Holtzman, Donald. “Les sept sages de la forêt des bambous et la société de leur temps.” T’oung Pao 44 (1956): 317-346.
  • Knaul, Livia. “Lost Chuang-tzu Passages.” Journal of Chinese Religions 10 (1982): 53-79.
    • This article contains a translation of the “lost” postface, as well as a detailed treatment of the Xiang Xiu controversy.
  • Knaul, Livia. “The Winged Life: Kuo Hsiang’s Mystical Philosophy.” Journal of Chinese Studies 2.1 (1985): 17-41.
  • Kohn, Livia. Early Chinese Mysticism: Philosophy and Soteriology in the Taoist Tradition. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1992.
  • Kohn, Livia. “Kuo Hsiang and the Chuang-tzu.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 12 (1985): 429-447.
  • Mair, Victor H., ed. Experimental Essays on Chuang-tzu. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1983.
  • Mather, Richard B. “The Controversy Over Conformity and Naturalness During the Six Dynasties.” History of Religions 9 (1969-1970): 160-180.
  • Robinet, Isabelle. “Kouo Siang ou le monde comme absolu.” T’oung Pao 69 (1983): 73-107.
  • Tang Yijie. Guo Xiang. Taibei: Dongda tushugongsi, 1999.
    • One of the most acclaimed biographers of Guo Xiang. Not currently translated into English.
  • Yü, Ying-shih. “Individualism and the Neo-Taoist Movement in Wei-Chin China.” In Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald Munro (Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985), 121-155.
  • Ziporyn, Brook. The Penumbra Unbound: The Neo-Taoist Philosophy of Guo Xiang. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.
  • Ziporyn, Brook. “The Self-So and Its Traces in the Thought of Guo Xiang.” Philosophy East and West 43 (1993): 511-539.
  • Zhuang Yaolang. Guo Xiang xuanxue. Taibei: Liren shuju, 2002.

Author Information

J. Scot Brackenridge
Email: Scot.Brackenridge@liu.edu
Long Island University
U. S. A.

Religious Language

The term “religious language” refers to statements or claims made about God or gods. Here is a typical philosophical problem of religious language. If God is infinite, then words used to describe finite creatures might not adequately describe God. For example, is God good in the same sense that Secretary-General of the United Nations Kofi Annan is good? This difficulty challenges us to articulate the degree that attributes used for finite beings can be used for God and what these attributes mean when they describe God. The ambiguity in meaning with respect to the terms predicated of God is the “problem of religious language” or the “problem of naming God.” These predications could include divine attributes, properties, or actions. Since the doctrines of the divine in Eastern religious traditions differ radically from the doctrines of the Abrahamic traditions, the problem of religious language has not been accorded much attention in Eastern philosophy.

The problem of religious language is worrisome to practitioners of the Abrahamic religious traditions because it has the potential to undermine those traditions. All three faiths proclaim truths about God in written texts, commentary traditions, and oral teachings. In fact, speech about God is essential to both personal praxis and organized celebration in these traditions. Without adequate solution to the problem of religious language, human speech about God is called into question. Without the ability to speak about God and to understand the meaning of what is spoken, the Abrahamic faiths are vulnerable to the criticism that their sacred texts and teachings are unintelligible.

The problem of religious language also provides a challenge for philosophers of religion. If there is no adequate solution to the problem of religious language, large discussions in the domain of philosophy of religion will also be rendered unintelligible. For example, philosophers of religion debate the nature of divine foreknowledge and human freedom. These claims about God would be rendered unintelligible if human speech about God is impossible. Thus, the problem of religious language is a philosophical problem that must be solved in order to provide a framework for understanding claims about God in both the house of worship and the academy.

Table of Contents

  1. What Generates the Problem of Religious Language?
  2. Solutions to the Problem
    1. Statements about God are Meaningless
    2. Other Possible Solutions: An Overview
      1. Equivocal Language
      2. Univocal Language
      3. Analogical Language
  3. Conclusion
  4. References and Further Reading

1. What Generates the Problem of Religious Language?

In contemporary discussions, it is not the question of God’s existence that generates the problem of religious language. If God does not exist, any attempt to describe God will be an inaccurate description of reality. Discussions about religious language attempt to articulate how one could speak of God if, in fact, God exists. The problem of religious language is generated by the traditional doctrine of God in the Abrahamic traditions. Since God is thought to be incorporeal, infinite, and timeless, the predicates we apply to corporeal, finite, temporal creatures would not apply to God.

The problem of religious language is also generated by the medieval doctrine of divine simplicity, which claims that God does not have any intrinsic accidental properties. Intrinsic properties are distinguished from Cambridge properties, such that the acquisition or loss of a Cambridge property by a subject does not entail a change in that subject, while the acquisition or loss of an intrinsic property by a subject entails a change in that subject. Moreover, accidental properties are distinguished from essential properties such that if a subject were to acquire or lose an accidental property, the subject would still be a member of its species. However, if a subject were to acquire a new essential property or lose an essential property, that subject would no longer be a member of its species. Thus, statements such as, “God is P,” where P is an intrinsic accidental property would be ruled out by divine simplicity. For example, the statement, “Kofi Annan is good,” means that some property goodness is a property of Kofi. When one says, “God is good,” it would appear that this statement means that some property goodness is a property of God. But if the doctrine of divine simplicity is true, it is impossible that God have the intrinsic accidental property of goodness. Rather, God is goodness. That is, God’s essence includes goodness and God is identical with his essence. Consequently, whenever someone applies a positive attribute to God they are speaking falsely, for God does not have properties in the way that creatures have properties. Although divine simplicity is a doctrine associated with medieval thinkers, it has been defended in the twentieth century by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann, among others.

2. Solutions to the Problem

Historically, there have been at least four different solutions to the problem of religious language. Although no single solution has been widely accepted by the philosophical community, some of the solutions have fallen into disrepute.

a. Statements about God are Meaningless

Some philosophers have argued that statements about God do not have truth-values and are thus meaningless or unintelligible. These claims are derived from the views of the Vienna Circle, a group of early twentieth century logical empiricists who developed a test for the truth-value of statements known as Verificationism.

Rudolf Carnap (1891-1970) argued that the only way one could be certain of a statement’s truth or falsity was by verifying those statements through perceptions, observations, or experience. He offers the following example of the process by which a statement could be verified:

Let us take the statement P1: “This key is made of iron.” There are many ways of verifying this statement: for example,: I place the key near a magnet; then I perceive that the key is attracted.

Here the deduction is made in this way: Premises: P1: “This key is made of iron”; The statement to be examined. P2: “If an iron thing is placed near a magnet, it is attracted;” this is a physical law, already verified.

P3: “This object – a bar – is a magnet;” statement already verified.

P4: “The key is placed near the bar;” this is now directly verified by our observation.

From these four premises we can deduce the conclusion: P5: “The key will now be attracted by the bar.”

This statement is a prediction which can be examined by observation. If we look, we either observe the attraction or we do not. In the first case we have found a positive instance, an instance of verification of the statement P1 under consideration; in the second case we have a negative instance, an instance of disproof of P1. (Carnap 1966, 208).

Having established the principle of verification, Carnap then argues that metaphysical assertions such as, “The principle of the world is water,” cannot be verified. (Ibid. 210). Since metaphysical assertions cannot be verified, they are meaningless. One cannot assess the truth-value of a metaphysical assertion because such assertions cannot be empirically verified.

A.J. Ayer (1910-1989) agreed with Carnap, and thus inferred that since all statements about God cannot be verified, they too are meaningless, “But the notion of a person whose essential attributes are non-empirical is not an intelligible notion at all. We may have a word which is used as if it names this ‘person,’ [God] but, unless the sentences in which it occurs express propositions which are empirically verifiable, it cannot be said to symbolize anything.” (Ayer 1946, 144). Thus, on the basis of Verificationism, statements about God do not have truth-values that can be verified and, thus, are unintelligible expressions. So at least one solution to the problem of religious language is to claim that statements about God are unintelligible.

But Verificationism was challenged by philosophers such as Alonzo Church and Richard Swinburne and largely abandoned in the twentieth century. A.J. Ayer identified and defended a “weak principle of verification” in his seminal paper, “The Principle of Verifiability.” He admitted that empirical propositions are not conclusively verifiable, but argued that in order for a claim to be factual, and thus to have its truth-value determined, it must be verifiable by some possible observations. (Ayer 1936, 199). While Ayer didn’t specify exactly what those possible observations must be, he argued that they need to be the kinds of observations that could verify an assertion.

In response, Richard Swinburne argues that the premises defending weak Verificationism are false. He offers the following example of an argument in defense of weak Verificationism: “It is claimed that a man could not understand a factual claim unless he knew what it would be like to observe it to hold or knew which observations would count for or against it; from which it follows that a statement could not be factually meaningful unless there could be observational evidence which would count for or against it.” (Swinburne 2000, 151).

Swinburne then argues that the premise of the above argument is false, since one could understand a statement if one understands the words forming that statement and if those words are organized in a grammatically significant format. Thus, there could be factual statements that do not have evidence either for or against them and one could understand them. Consequently, metaphysical assertions invoking God and his properties cannot be ruled out as meaningless by weak Verificationism.

Ayer modified his principle of verification for the second edition of his book, Language, Truth and Logic, as follows:

A statement is directly verifiable if it is either itself an observation-statement, or is such that in conjunction with one or more observation-statements it entails at least one observation-statement which is not deducible from these other premises alone; and I propose to say that a statement is indirectly verifiable if it satisfies the following conditions: first, that in conjunction with certain other premises it entails one or more directly verifiable statements which are not deducible from these other premises alone; and secondly, that these other premises do not include any statement that is not either analytic, or directly verifiable, or capable of being independently established as indirectly verifiable. (Ayer 1946, 13).

In a review of the second edition, Alonzo Church argued that even according to Ayer’s revised principle of verification, any statement whatsoever or its negation is verifiable:

For let O1, O2, O3 be three “observation-statements” (or “experiential propositions”) such that no one of the three taken alone entails any of the others. Then using these we may show of any statement S whatever that either it or its negation is verifiable, as follows. Let –O1 and –S be the negations of O1 and S respectively. Then (under Ayer’s definition) –O1O2 v O3–S is directly verifiable, because with O1 it entails O3. Moreover S and –O1O2 v O3–S together entail O2. Therefore (under Ayer’s definition) S is indirectly verifiable – unless it happens that –O1O2 v O3–S alone entails O2 , in which case –S and O3 together entail O2 , so that –S is directly verifiable. (Church 1949, 53).

Church’s objection was so devastating, that Ayer’s definition of verifiability from the second edition of his book was largely abandoned. Despite repeated attempts by various thinkers such as Kai Neilson to reformulate a principle of verification successfully, Verificationism has been continually rejected as an inadequate methodology. As Ruth Weintraub points out in a recent paper, almost no one defends Verificationism in the twenty-first century. (Weintraub 2003, 83).

b. Other Possible Solutions: An Overview

There are at least three solutions to the problem of religious language other than the view that statements about God are meaningless. The first solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are equivocal with respect to what they mean in reference to God and what they mean in reference to creatures. Consequently, this solution would argue that God is not good in the same sense in which Kofi is good; God’s goodness is entirely different from the goodness of a creature. Despite this tremendous difference in kind, God can be spoken of by human beings through negations. Rabbi Moses ben Maimon (Maimonides) (1135-1204) is one of the most famous proponents of this doctrine. He argued for this position in his Guide for the Perplexed. His view has been defended in the twentieth century by, among others, Harry Austryn Wolfson (1887-1974) and Kenneth Seeskin (1947- ).

The second solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are univocal with respect to what they mean in reference to God and what they mean in reference to creatures. This approach would argue that God is good in the same sense in which Kofi is good. In the contemporary literature William Alston argues that there are some concepts that can be applied univocally to God and to human beings, but he rejects a completely univocal solution.

The third solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are used analogously. This solution argues that God is good in an analogous sense to Kofi’s goodness. “Good” applied to both God and to Kofi would signify the same thing, but in different modes. That is, when “good” is applied to Kofi it picks out a property of Kofi, but when “good” is applied to God, it refers to the unity that is God’s essence and not to an individual property. This approach provides a middle position between an equivocal solution and a univocal solution, since terms used analogously aren’t entirely equivocal nor are they entirely univocal; terms used analogously signify the same thing but in different modes. This is the approach of St. Thomas Aquinas (1225-1274). He defends this position in his Summa theologiae as well as his Summa contra Gentiles. The analogical approach as been defended in the contemporary literature by a number of philosophers, including Ralph McInerny (1929-).

i. Equivocal Language

Maimonides, like Aquinas, is committed to the doctrine of divine simplicity, as it is described in Section 1 above. It is for this reason that he rejects affirmative attributes with respect to God, with some exceptions. Although it is accurate to characterize Maimonides’ solution to the problem of religious language as equivocal, it certainly includes more than just equivocations. One can speak of God through negations. For example, one can say, “God is not dead,” in order to signify that God lives. One can speak of God also through naming the divine actions, such as, “God creates.” However, the Maimonidean attribute of action is not to be understood as identical with the Aristotelian accident of action. Attributes of action are understood to be events by Maimonides, while Aristotle (384-322 BCE) understands actions to be accidents or properties that inhere in a substance. Since Maimonidean attributes of action are not properties, they do not abrogate divine simplicity.

One might oppose Maimonides on this point by arguing that actions imply composition in their subject, and thus that they would abrogate divine simplicity. For example, in the statement, “Zayd stood,” the fact that Zayd stands shows that Zayd has a special feature, namely, the ability or power to stand. So the action of standing implies that Zayd has the power to stand. This ability introduces composition in Zayd in that it shows that Zayd is composed of “the power to stand” among all his other properties. Consequently, Maimonides would be mistaken in arguing that actions do not introduce composition in their subject. In fact, it looks as if each action will introduce a separate power in the agent, thus multiplying the composition in the agent. So for every divine action, God will have a separate power in himself.

Maimonides addresses this objection by arguing that multiple actions could be brought about by a single power or ability. (Maimonides 1966, Vol. I, 53). He uses the example of the heat generated by a fire, which can burn, blacken wood, cook food, and so forth. So, one should not assume that a multiplicity of actions entails a multiplicity of powers in the agent. In the fire example, the heat of the fire produces multiple actions. The same could be said about an agent who acts by virtue of his will. Consequently, Maimonides argues that God brings about multiple actions and effects through his will, which is contained in his essence but not as a property, and that the multiplicity of effects or actions does not entail a multiplicity of powers in God.

According to Maimonides, predicates such as qualities or relations are to be denied of God. For example, one should say, “God is not a body,” but one cannot say correctly, “God is merciful.” While there are biblical passages that contain some of these imperfections, they are written in the language of human beings. Maimonides attempts to interpret these passages to eliminate or to deny the imperfections. His foundational assumption is that these passages do not ascribe to God anything that could be viewed as a deficiency. For example, passages that refer to God’s “body parts” are to be interpreted as indicating God’s actions. Maimonides argues that when the Bible indicates that God has an eye, “eye” indicates the intellectual act of apprehension performed by God. This act of apprehension does not imply composition in God insofar as it is an attribute of action, so it can be attributed to God without compromising divine simplicity. Qualities that are attributed to God in the Bible, such as “merciful,” mean that God performs acts that resemble certain acts done by human beings out of a given quality such as mercy. But “merciful” does not indicate what God is like or what his nature is; “merciful” only refers to a certain kind of action. Taken as a quality, terms such as “merciful” are applied to God equivocally. So we cannot say that God has certain qualities such as “mercy” in the same sense in which we would say “Kofi is merciful,” because God’s simplicity precludes his having the quality of mercy. Nor can we speak of any relation of similarity between God and creatures. Relations are accidental properties and God does not have accidental properties. So any relation between God and another thing must be denied of God.

With respect to God, the so-called essential attributes (for example, living, existing, incorporeal, eternal, powerful, knowing, willing, and one) are interpreted equivocally. According to Maimonides, these attributes indicate composition in God and they purport to indicate a feature of God’s essence. In order to preserve divine simplicity, Maimonides interprets these attributes as signifying “the negation of the privation of the attribute in question” with respect to God. A privation is the absence of the existence of a habit. For example, blindness would be a privation of sight. So one could say, “The wall does not see.” Maimonides would not say that the wall is blind, because the only things that could be blind are those things that could or should have the capacity for sight. A wall never has the capacity for sight, although a wall is unseeing. So the negation of the privation of the attribute of seeing in the case of the wall indicates that the property of sight is not fittingly said of the wall, even in a negative sense. In the case of God, essential attributes are to be interpreted as indicating that those attributes are not fittingly said of God, even in a negative sense. For example, “God is living,” would be interpreted to signify, “God is not dead,” which is taken to mean that “dead” is not fittingly said of God. A similar procedure is to be followed for the other essential attributes, none of which are appropriately said of God, even in negations.

In summary, according to Maimonides, we can only say what God is not and what actions he performs. The standard objection to Maimonides’ solution is that it is incompatible with the religious practices and assumptions of his own tradition, Judaism, and with those of the other Western monotheisms. Aquinas argues that an equivocal approach to God would undermine religious practices. Any demonstration about God would be formally invalid, as it would include an equivocation. Any communication about God would be severely limited because we cannot make any affirmative claims about God or his nature. Given that the divine actions are named equivocally through a perceived similarity to creaturely actions, how can human beings know what they mean? Even through the divine actions, God is unknowable. Consequently, Aquinas argues that one should look for a means of naming God that does not fall prey to these problems and that is in keeping with religious practices. It is on this basis that he defends the way of analogy as a preferable solution.

It is important to note that Maimonides’ pessimism with respect to what can be said about God is derived largely from his metaphysical commitment to divine simplicity. If this commitment were removed, then Maimonides would have more latitude with respect to religious language. However, other religious doctrines in the Abrahamic traditions preclude a wholly univocal solution to the problem, as will become evident in the next section.

ii. Univocal Language

A modern proponent of univocity is William Alston. Alston, however, does not defend complete univocity, in which ordinary terms are used in the same sense of God and creatures, because he recognizes that divine otherness, especially divine incorporeality, would preclude complete univocity. (Alston 1989a, 65). However, he argues that two different things could possess the same abstract feature in different ways,

A meeting and a train of thought can both be “orderly” even though what it is for the one to be orderly is enormously different from what it is for the other to be orderly. A new computer and a new acquaintance can both be “intriguing” in a single sense of the term, even though what makes the one intriguing is very different from what makes the other intriguing. (Ibid., 66-67).

Having pointed out that two different kinds of things can possess the same abstract feature in different ways, Alston argues that God and human beings can possess the same abstract feature in different ways. For example, a human being can know a particular fact and God can know that same fact. But how God knows something or the way that God knows something will be different from the way that a human being knows something insofar as God is incorporeal, omniscient, and so forth. According to Alston, the difference in the way knowledge is acquired doesn’t prevent us from saying that the psychological concept, “knows p,” can be applied to both human beings and to God. Moreover, one can also apply functionalist concepts, which are concepts of a certain functional role in the psyche, to both human beings and to God. Alston offers the following description of functionalist concepts,

The concept of a belief, desire or intention is the concept of a particular function in the psychological economy, a particular “job” done by the psyche. A belief is a structure that performs that job, and what psychological state it is – that it is a belief and a belief with that particular content – is determined by what that job is . . . . Our ordinary psychological terms carry no implications as to the intrinsic nature of the structure, its neurophysiological or soul-stuff character. . . . Thus, on this view, psychological concepts are functional in the same way as many concepts of artifacts, for example, the concept of a loudspeaker. (Ibid., 67-68).

Since functionalist concepts are indifferent as to the nature of the structure of the psyche in which they inhere, it is possible to apply a functionalist concept to both a human being and to God in the same sense. According to Alston:

We can say of a human being that she will tend to do what she can to bring about what she recognizes to be best in a given situation, and we can take this tendency to be partly constitutive of the concept of recognizing something to be best. We can then formulate the divine regularities in tendency terms also. Thus it will be true of God also that if He recognizes that it is good that p He will tend to bring about p insofar as He can unless He recognizes something incompatible with p to be a greater good. (Ibid., 79).

Alston claims that this example illustrates his method of applying functionalist concepts to God and to human beings univocally. According to Alston, the tendency statements are true of God, but the core of common meaning between human beings and God is to be found in the concept of “recognizing something to be best.” Alston further claims that although both God and human beings can be said to perform the function “recognizing something to be best,” human beings do not always assess the situation correctly, but God does. Since God and human beings perform the same function, albeit in a different way, the functionalist concept “recognizing something to be best” can be applied truly to both entities with a common core of meaning. So it would be true to say of God that he recognizes something to be best and that this concept can be applied to him and to human beings in the same sense. Thus, Alston argues that functionalist concepts can be constructed in such a way that they apply in the same sense to God and creatures, and he identifies this position as “partial univocity.”

At least one of the limitations of Alston’s view is that the predicates that are frequently used of God in the historical religious traditions, for example, “good,” and that are applied also to human beings cannot be applied univocally to God; only constructed terms, for example, “recognizing something to be best,” could be applied univocally to God. Therefore, with respect to the historical religious traditions, Alston’s view is not of much help. A religious believer, for example, might ask herself the question whether or not God could be said truly to be good. Alston can’t provide an answer to this question, because he intentionally limits partial univocity to functionalist concepts. If goodness could be expressed in a functionalist concept such as “recognizing something to be best,” then God could be said truly to possess this predicate in the same sense as a human being who shares the same predicate. But functionalist concepts are descriptive of mental states and so one might wonder if the equation of goodness with a particular mental state is a sufficiently robust description of goodness.

Second, one might wonder why Alston believes that God performs the same functions as human beings, given divine otherness. Presumably, he would argue that mental states would be the same in two minds, regardless of how the minds are constructed or out of what materials they are constructed. Granting this point, on what basis does Alston reject complete univocity between the functionalist concepts of the two minds? If the nature and constituents of their minds does not prevent the two minds from having the same mental state, why would Alston deny that there is a complete univocity between them? Complete univocity is probably denied because of divine otherness. But divine otherness has to do with, for example, divine incorporeality. Divine incorporeality would impinge upon how God’s mind is constructed, but this would be irrelevant for the functionalist concepts. One wonders if Alston should be committed to a completely univocal view, given his account of functionalist concepts.

Given the limitations of Alston’s view and some of the unanswered questions that arise concerning it, it is appropriate to turn our attention to the third possible solution to religious language, which is the view of St. Thomas Aquinas.

iii. Analogical Language

Aquinas argues that the when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are used analogously. Thus, when the predicate “good” is applied to God, it doesn’t pick out a property that God has. Owing to divine simplicity, God does not have properties. When predicated of God, “good” refers to the unity that is God’s essence. So when “good” is attributed to God and to Kofi, it signifies the same thing in both attributions, but it signifies this thing in different modes.

Aquinas grounds his analogical approach in the causal relation that obtains between God and creatures. In his discussion of analogy, Aquinas outlines the following points:

1) Human beings name things as they know them (Aquinas, Ia,.13.1).
2) Human beings know God from creatures.
3) God causes the existence of creatures (Ibid., 12.8).
4) Creatures resemble God just as an effect resembles its agent cause.

On the basis of the resemblance between creatures and God, human beings can infer that certain perfections of created things are present in God and they can name these perfections. Thus, the foundation for an analogy of names between creatures and God is the causal relationship that holds between God and creatures. >

Aquinas affirms the principle that effects resemble their efficient or agent causes. His account of the similarity between an agent cause and its effect includes a shared form. According to Aquinas, there are at least two different kinds of forms: substantial forms and accidental forms. Substantial forms configure the matter or physical stuff in which they inhere. They contribute a set of essential properties to a substance, such as rationality. A substantial form is the essence of a substance, which is a matter-form composite such as a human being. Accidental forms are non-essential properties, such as perfections or qualities. Aquinas explains that creaturely perfections are associated with both substantial forms and accidental forms;

“God alone is good essentially. For everything is called good according to its perfection. Now perfection of a thing is threefold: first, according to the constitution of its own being; secondly, in respect of any accidents being added as necessary for its perfect operation […] Thus, for instance, the first perfection of fire consists in its existence, which it has through its own substantial form; its secondary perfection consists in heat, lightness and dryness […] This […] perfection belongs to no creature by its own essence; it belongs to God only, in Whom alone essence is existence; in Whom there are no accidents; since whatever belongs to others accidentally belongs to Him essentially, as, to be powerful, wise, and the like.” (Ibid., 6.3.).

According to Aquinas, there is a perfection associated with a thing’s substantial form and there are the added perfections that attach to the essence of a thing as accidents. In both cases, these perfections are derived from God. However, insofar as the shared forms are found in more eminent mode in God than in a creature, the creature will be less perfect than God. Consequently, the shared form cannot share a univocal name. However, the shared forms are not wholly different (otherwise they couldn’t be shared) and so they cannot share an equivocal name. Thus, Aquinas argues that the shared forms also share an analogical name, which would be neither univocal nor equivocal. So human beings can name God’s perfections by way of analogy, on the basis of the causal relationship that holds between God and creatures. It is on this basis that one could say, “God is good,” and, “Kofi is good,” where “good” is understood to be said truly of both God and Kofi, even though God is good essentially and Kofi possesses goodness only as an accidental property.

Despite the similarities that exist between God and creatures, there are many ways in which creatures do not resemble God. So when one names God, one must be cognizant of the differences between God and creatures as well as the similarities so that one does not make a false attribution to God. So although Aquinas thinks that God can be named on the basis of the resemblance that holds between him and creatures, Aquinas acknowledges that this resemblance is limited and that therefore not all terms that are correctly applied to creatures may be correctly applied to God. For example, any terms indicating corporeality cannot be applied to God since God is incorporeal.

In order to affirm the naming of God by analogy along with the doctrine of simplicity, Aquinas makes a distinction between the mode of signification of a name (modus significandi) and the thing signified by a name (res significata). This distinction is not made by Maimonides, so he is unable to use it in his attempt to provide a solution to the problem of religious language. Owing to divine simplicity, the divine names will be different in mode than the same names as applied to creatures. For example, when “good” is applied to a creature it will signify that the property “goodness” inheres in the creature. However, when “good” is applied to God it will signify that “goodness” is somehow included in God’s essence, but not as a property. The mode of signification of human language is inherently defective with respect to God since it always picks out predicates as accidental properties. God doesn’t have accidental properties. In contrast, the thing signified by names such as “good” belongs properly to God and more so to God than to creatures, since any goodness that could be found in a creature is derived from God as the creator. One could say, “Kofi Annan is good,” and one could say, “God is good,” where “good” is included in God’s essence in a higher mode and to a greater degree than the property “goodness” inheres in Kofi Annan.

One might think that with respect to perfection terms the thing signified would be applied univocally between God and creatures. But, according to Aquinas, things are named univocally when they have both the same name and the same definition of the name. The definition of the name would include both the mode of signification and the thing signified by the name. So in the case of perfection terms applied to God and to creatures, the thing signified by the name would be the same but the mode of signification would be different. So although the thing signified would be the same, the name would not be said univocally between God and creatures. God’s perfection isn’t a matter of quantity such that he just has more perfection than a creature does. The manner in which he possesses a given perfection is different from the manner in which a creature possesses that same perfection, since God is simple and creatures are not.

One might think that if we reject divine simplicity, all reasons for naming God analogically would disappear. But this isn’t quite right. As Alston points out, the problem of religious language can be generated by divine otherness. So even absent divine simplicity, Aquinas would be likely to argue for an analogy between creatures and God. However, Aquinas doesn’t limit his approach to religious language solely to analogies. He also approves of naming God by virtue of negations, but he doesn’t limit speech about God to negations.

Alston provides a recent objection to Aquinas’ analogical solution. He argues that serious problems arise in connection with the thing signified by the name, as Aquinas understands it. This is so because Aquinas is unable to specify completely God’s perfections. Moreover, he cannot make explicit what likeness holds between God and creatures because all names fall short of him. According to Alston, there are too many ambiguities in Aquinas’ view.

But Aquinas has an answer to this objection in his recourse to the principle that every effect is like its agent cause. Aquinas knows this principle in general based upon observations of other agent causes, such as artisans who craft artifacts, and he applies this principle to God by virtue of the arguments that God is the first efficient (agent) cause. (Aquinas, Ia., 2.3). Thus, God cannot be wholly different from creatures in the way that Alston suspects.

Alston argues that since the thing signified by the name is indeterminate with respect to God, we cannot know, for example, what “God is good” means. But Aquinas would take issue with the inference from the first claim to the second, on the grounds of the relationship between created effects and God. Perfections such as goodness are found both in the created effect and in God, but in God they are found in a different mode and to a greater degree. So “God is good” is not meaningless nor is it the case that we do not know what “God is good” means. We know that goodness is found in God somehow, in a different mode and to a different degree. So “God is good” is a true statement. In fact, “good” is said primarily of God, rather than creatures, because “good” is given to creatures via the causal relationship. The thing signified by “good” is indeterminate in the sense that we do not know exactly to what degree it is found in God, except that the mode is different and the degree is greater than that found in creatures. But this degree of indeterminateness does not entail the kind of agnosticism about the divine attributes that Alston suggests. Consequently, Alston’s objection is unsuccessful.

Despite the virtues of Aquinas’ approach to naming God, there are some obvious drawbacks for his view. In particular, his view requires a medieval metaphysics that most contemporary philosophers would find questionable. For example, he believes in a causal relation between creatures and God. However, in comparison with the other two solutions and their respective disadvantages, Aquinas makes a strong case in favor of his view.

3. Conclusion

With respect to the problem of religious language, multiple solutions have been suggested and defended. Four of these solutions have been presented in this entry. The first solution suggests that all statements about God are meaningless. The second solution suggests that all attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted equivocally. The third solution suggests that the attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted univocally. The fourth solution suggests that the attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted analogously.

While no single solution has emerged to the satisfaction of all religious communities or philosophers of religion, three of the historical solutions offer a way in which statements about God might be understood. Maimonides’ solution severely limits the degree to which human beings can speak about God. Alston’s solution raises at least two objections that require a satisfactory response and a possible modification of his proposal. Finally, the solution of Aquinas requires a medieval metaphysic in which one affirms the relation of creation between creatures and God, a foundation many contemporary individuals would reject. Consequently, there is much research and thought that is still to be done on the problem of religious language. The historical solutions offered here provide a tenuous beginning in that direction and show promise for the emergence of a satisfactory solution.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Alston, William P. “Religious Language.” In The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Religion. Ed. William J. Wainwright. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005. pp. 220-244.
  • Alston, William P. “Aquinas on Theological Predication: A Look Backward and A Look Forward.” In Reasoned Faith: Essays in Philosophical Theology in Honor of Norman Kretzmann. Ed. Eleonore Stump. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1993.
    • Alston provides several objections to Aquinas’ analogical solution to the problem of religious language.
  • Alston, William P. “Functionalism and Theological Language.” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989a.
  • Alston, William P. “Can We Speak Literally of God?” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989b.
  • Alston, William P. “Divine and Human Action.” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989c.
  • Aquinas, Saint Thomas. Summa Theologiae. Trans. by Fathers of the English Dominican Province. New York: Benziger Bros., 1948.
    • Aquinas’ most famous work, which summarizes his views on a variety of theological and philosophical topics.
  • Aristotle. Categories and On Interpretation. Trans. Hugh Tredinnick. Loeb Classical Library. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1938.
    • Two of Aristotle’s logical works, which include discussions of actions, accidents, logic and the truth-conditions of assertions.
  • Ayer, A. J. “The Principle of Verifiability.” In Mind. vol. 45, no. 178 (Apr 1936), pp. 199-203.
    • Ayer’s defense of weak Verificationism.
  • Ayer, A. J. “God-Talk is Evidently Nonsense.” In Philosophy of Religion. Ed. Brian Davies. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000. pp. 143-147.
    • In this extract from his book, Language, Truth and Logic, Ayer argues that since assertions about God cannot be empirically verified that they are therefore meaningless.
  • Ayer, A. J. Language, Truth and Logic. 2nd ed. New York: Dover Publications: 1946.
  • Carnap, Rudolf. “Philosophy and Logical Syntax: Part I.” In 20th-Century Philosophy: The Analytic Tradition. Ed. Morris Weitz. New York: The Free Press, 1966. pp. 207-219.
    • Carnap’s groundbreaking lecture on Verificationism and its implications for metaphysics.
  • Church, Alonzo. “Review of A.J. Ayer’s Language, Truth and Logic, Second Edition,” in Journal of Symbolic Logic. vol. 14, no. 1, (March 1949), pp. 52-53.
  • Konyndyk, Kenneth. “Verificationism and Dogmatism” in International Journal for Philosophy of Religion. vol. 8, no. 1 (1977), pp. 1-17.
    • In this article, Konyndyk canvasses Kai Neilsen’s attempts to formulate a successful principle of verification and argues that each formulation is unclear and ambiguous.
  • Kretzmann, Norman and Eleonore Stump, Eds. The Cambridge Companion to Aquinas. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
  • Maimonides, Moses. The Guide of the Perplexed. 2 vols. Trans. Shlomo Pines. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1963.
    • Maimonides’ famous work, which summarizes his views on a variety of theological and philosophical topics, and includes various polemics against Islamic theologians.
  • McInerny, Ralph. Aquinas and Analogy. Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 1996.
  • Neilsen, Kai. Contemporary Critiques of Religion. (London: Weidenfeld and Nicolson, 1973).
    • In this work, Neilsen offers his own principle of Verification, which is subsequently criticized by Kenneth Konyndyk.
  • Seeskin, Kenneth. “Sanctity and Silence: The Religious Significance of Maimonides’ Negative Theology.” In American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly. 76 (2002): pp. 7-24.
  • Seeskin, Kenneth, Ed. The Cambridge Companion to Maimonides. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
  • Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. “Absolute Simplicity.” In Faith and Philosophy. 2, (1985), pp. 353-382.
    • A contemporary defense of the medieval doctrine of divine simplicity.
  • Stump, Eleonore. Aquinas. New York: Routledge Press, 2003.
    • A contemporary articulation and defense of many of Aquinas’ most important views on topics both theological and philosophical, including an excellent treatment of Aquinas’ views on form.
  • Swinburne, Richard. “God-Talk is not evidently nonsense.” In Philosophy of Religion. Ed. Brian Davies. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000. pp. 147-152.
    • In this extract from his book, The Coherence of Theism, Swinburne argues that weak Verificationism is founded on a false premise.
  • Weed, Jennifer Hart. Creation as a Foundation of Analogy in Aquinas,” forthcoming in Divine Transcendence and Immanence in the Thought of St. Thomas Aquinas (Leuven: Peeters, 2006).
    • A contemporary analysis of Aquinas’ account of divine causality and the kind of resemblance that holds between creatures and their creator, with a brief discussion of how this resemblance functions in Aquinas’ method of naming God analogically.
  • Weed, Jennifer Hart. “Maimonides and Aquinas: A Medieval Misunderstanding?” In Revista Portuguesa de Filosofia. Forthcoming in 2006.
    • A contemporary comparison between Maimonides’ via negativa and Aquinas’ way of analogy, along with a re-examination of Aquinas’ alleged misunderstanding of Maimonides’ method.
  • Weintraub, Ruth. “Verificationism Revisited,” in Ratio. Vol. XVI, (March 2003), pp. 83-98.
    • In this paper, Weintraub points out that almost no one defends Verificationism in the contemporary philosophical community.
  • Wolfson, Harry Autryn. Studies in the History of Philosophy and Religion. Eds. Isadore Twersky and George H. Williams. 2 vols. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1977.
    • A collection of Wolfson’s papers, primarily on Jewish philosophy and medieval philosophy.

Author Information

Jennifer Hart Weed
Email: jweed@unb.ca
University of New Brunswick
Canada

Mental Causation

The term “mental causation” applies to causal transactions involving mental events or states, such as beliefs, desires, feelings, and perceptions. Typically, the term is used to refer to cases where a mental state causes a physical reaction: for instance, the mental state of perceiving a Frisbee flying your way can cause the physical event of your springing up to catch it. It should also be recognized that mental causation covers those cases where the causal transaction occurs just among mental states themselves, as when one entertains a series of thoughts while planning, deliberating, solving a problem, remembering, and so on. The term “mental causation” need not cover such exotica as minds bending spoons (if such feats are to be believed), psychosomatic illnesses, or controlling one’s body through yogic meditation. Simply waving your hand (a physical event) because you wish to greet a friend (a mental event) suffices for counting as an instance of mental causation.

The phenomenon of mental causation, as may be apparent, is thoroughly commonplace and ubiquitous. But this is not the only reason why it is significant. It is absolutely fundamental to our concept of actions performed intentionally (as opposed to involuntarily), which, in turn, is central to those of agency, free will, and moral responsibility. An action, as philosophers use the term, is not a mere bodily motion like involuntarily blinking one’s eyes. It is something one does intentionally, as when one winks to grab someone’s attention. The distinction between a mere bodily movement and an action hinges on the possibility of mental causation, since actions have mental states, such as intentions, as direct causes. This distinction, in turn, is critical for gauging moral responsibility, since we attribute or withhold judgments of moral responsibility depending upon whether the agent acted intentionally.

While the phenomenon of mental causation seems obvious enough, the explanation of how it is possible is far from obvious. There are certain putative marks distinctive of mental states that pose problems for their capacity to wield causal powers, marks such as: being a non-physical substance (problem of spatial location and problem of conservation); failing to conform to law-like regularities (problem of anomalism); being extrinsic to an agent’s body (problem of externalism); and being supplanted by brain states (problem of exclusion).

Table of Contents

  1. Background to the Problem of Mental Causation
    1. Dualism v. Reductive Materialism
    2. Substance Dualism v. Property Dualism
    3. Standard Models of Mind-Body Interaction
      1. Interactionism
      2. Parallelism
      3. Epiphenomenalism
      4. Reductionism
  2. Traditional Problem of Mental Causation
    1. The Problem of Spatial Location
    2. The Problem of Conservation
  3. Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
    1. Background to the Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
      1. Token Physicalism
      2. The Causal Efficacy of Events Versus the Causal Relevance of Properties
      3. A Test for Causal Relevance
    2. Three Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
      1. Problem of Anomalism
        1. The Appeal to Ceteris Paribus Laws
        2. The Appeal to Counterfactuals
      2. Problem of Externalism
        1. The Appeal to Narrow Content (Internalism)
        2. The Appeal to Wide Causation
      3. Problem of Exclusion
        1. Reduction Strategy
        2. Supervenience Strategy
        3. Realization Strategy
        4. The Dual Explanandum Strategy
  4. Conclusion: Where We Are Now
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Background to the Problem of Mental Causation

a. Dualism v. Reductive Materialism

The main assumption that generates problems for mental causation is dualism, the view that mental phenomena and physical phenomena are fundamentally different from each other. In particular, the mental is not reducible to the physical: constructing a physical duplicate of a conscious person does not guarantee that the physical duplicate has a mind. René Descartes (1596 – 1650) is the classic source for defenses of dualism. The view that the mental is so reducible is known as reductive materialism, which maintains that mental phenomena are nothing but a species of physical phenomena, which consist of purely physical substances, physical properties, and physical laws governing their behavior.

Reductive materialism does not face the problem of mental causation, because mental causation, being nothing more than a species of physical causation, is no more problematic than just plain old physical causation. Not so for dualism.

b. Substance Dualism v. Property Dualism

Dualism comes in two main versions: substance dualism and property dualism. Standard discussions divide the issue along the traditional problem of mental causation and the contemporary problem of mental causation. The former is generated by the form of dualism known as substance dualism, while the latter generated by what is known as property dualism. It is actually more accurate to say of both problems that there are several sub-problems associated with each.

Substance dualism comes out of the traditional Christian conception of a person as consisting of both a body and a soul that can survive the destruction of the body. Descartes offered the most fully developed formulation of substance dualism (also called “Cartesian dualism,” after its founder), so called because the idea is that the mind and the body constitute each their own “substance.” A substance, on Descartes’s view, is anything that can logically exist on its own, where something can logically exist on its own if one can coherently conceive of that individual without having to conceive of it with anything else – a pumpkin, a cow, a ball of wax; things that are not substances would be things like a sense of humor or a friendly smile, as they need to be a part of something else in order for us to conceive of them coherently (a person, in the case of humor, and a face, in the case of a smile). Descartes’s formulation of substance dualism maintains that the mind has no physical features – no mass, shape, spatial dimension, and so on. The mind, in other words, has no physically detectable qualities. Furthermore, under this formulation, the body has no mental features. This basically means that the brain does not think, feel, or perceive, a rather odd view by today’s standards.

Property dualism, by contrast, allows for the brain to think, feel, and perceive, for it allows that all substances are physical, but it maintains that thoughts, feelings, and perceptions are instances of mental properties that are not reducible to physical properties. Properties, unlike substances, are repeatable; that is, a single property, such as the color orange, can occur in many different substances – a pumpkin and a squash can both be orange. Examples of mental properties are things like the belief that it is raining, the desire to stay dry, and other propositional attitudes, as well as sensations, like pains, itches, and tickles. According to property dualism, an individual who has exactly the same physical properties as a conscious person may still lack mental properties. Both property dualism and substance dualism allow for the possibility of what philosophers of mind call zombies. These are not the brain-dead stalkers of Hollywood, but rather creatures that are physically identical to a fully conscious individual that nonetheless lack a mental life. Property dualism and substance dualism differ in that substance dualism entails property dualism, but the converse is not true.

c. Standard Models of Mind-Body Interaction

There are four basic models of mind-body interaction. These are:

  1. interactionism, the view that the mind and the body directly cause things to happen in each other;
  2. parallelism, the view that the mind and the body act “in parallel,” but never casually interact directly;
  3. epiphenomenalism, the view that only the body has causal powers, but the mind is causally inert; and finally,
  4. reductionism, the view that the mind just is the body, and so whatever causal efficacy the physical has, the mental also has.

These models can each be formulated in terms of the vocabulary of either substance dualism or property dualism. In this entry, the models will be neutral between these two versions of dualism.

What these models say and how they differ are best understood when applied to a concrete example. Take the case where you have the misfortune of stubbing your toe. The trauma to your toe sends signals through nerves in your leg and torso that stimulate those neural tissues responsible for the capacity to experience pain – call them C-fibers, the neural correlate of pain. The crucial question is how the term “correlate” is specified: is the correlation causal or non-causal, and if causal, do the effects themselves have causal powers or not? The different models give us different answers to this question.

i. Interactionism

The critical feature of interactionism is its commitment to “two-way” causation – mental-to-physical causation and physical-to-mental causation. Here is the interactionist’s story. When you stub your toe (call this event a), this stimulates the C-fibers in your brain (call this event b). This neural event b causes you to experience the sensation of pain (event c.). The pain you feel causes you to get annoyed (event d), causing a neural event (e), which is the neural correlate of annoyance.

A diagram may be helpful here. Causal transactions are represented by arrows. Mental events (like pain and annoyance) go above the bar, and physical events (like stubbing your toe, C-fiber stimulation (CFS), and the neural correlate of annoyance (N)) go below it.

mental-causation-fig1

Objections to Interactionism: As the picture makes clear, causation flows from the mental to the physical and from the physical to the mental. Indeed, this is the hallmark of interactionism, which is depicted by the arrows from (b) to (c) and (d) to (e). Interactionism is probably the most common view held by the folk, but as will be explained below, it faces the problem of spatial location and the problem of conservation.

ii. Parallelism

Dualism does not necessarily entail interactionism, since one can be a dualist and yet maintain that there is no causal interaction between the mental and the physical. This is parallelism. On this model, mental and physical events do not causally interact; they only co-occur. When causal transactions do occur, they occur only between members of their own kind: mental events enter into causal transactions only with other mental events, and physical events enter into causal transactions only with other physical events.

mental-causation-fig2

Parallelism raises the following pressing question: what guarantees that the mental event and its physical correlate will be appropriately coordinated? Why do we feel pain upon bodily trauma on a regular basis, or seek water when we are thirsty rather than whistle a tune, or elevate our arm when we want to raise it rather than raise our foot? Our minds and bodies are remarkably well coordinated for two systems that are supposed to have no causal contact with each other.

There are two different accounts of how the coordination is achieved: pre-established harmony, the view of Gottfried Leibniz (1646 – 1716) and occasionalism, the view of Nicolas Malebranche (1638 – 1715). Both appeal crucially to God as the source of mind-body coordination. According to Leibniz’s pre-established harmony (1695), the proper pairing of a mental event and a bodily event was long established by God. As Leibniz explains, the mind and the body are like two separate clocks wound up in advance to chime at precisely the same time. On this view, God is thus fairly “hands-off” when it comes to coordinating an individual’s mind with her body, having done all the work ahead of time.

Not so on the view developed by Malebranche. According to Malebranche’s occasionalism, coordination is achieved on an event by event basis; whenever someone wants to raise her arm, God is right there to make her arm go up (Malebranche 1958, 2:316). The basis for this view stems out of a previous commitment to a certain view about causation according to which only God can bring about causes and effects.

Objections to Parallelism: To modern ears, this convenient appeal to God to solve the coordination problem is untenable and just too convenient. In defense of pre-established harmony and occasionalism, we need to understand that they are driven by prior commitments about the nature of God and the world as God created it, not simply introduced to solve a problem about mind-body coordination. However, those who reject the metaphysical schemes of Leibniz and of Malebranche will find these solutions unsatisfactory.

iii. Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism is the view that physical events cause mental events, but mental events never cause anything, not even other mental events. It is thus a partial concession to interactionism, as it allows for causation in “one direction” – from the physical to the mental – and so it denies parallelism, as it insists upon causal contact from the physical to the mental. The mind, on this model, is like a shadow cast by the body, where the body is the only thing that makes things happen – the mind is just “projected” and is causally inert. This analogy is inexact, for even shadows do darken the regions upon which they are cast, and at times, frighten or amuse or do other things. But mental events are not supposed to do anything, according to epiphenomenalism, not even cause other mental events.

mental-causation-fig3

As odd as the model may initially appear, there is a compelling motivation for it. It does not encounter the coordination problem faced by parallelism, because it allows for mental events to be causally grounded by their physical causes. Thus, the reason why, say, one feels pain upon stubbing one’s toe is that the stubbing causes the C-fiber stimulation, which then causes the pain in a law-like manner.

Objections to Epiphenomenalism: In spite of its stated virtues, epiphenomenalism has been thought to be unappealing, precisely because it does not credit the mind with any causal efficacy. Consequently, epiphenomenalism is logically consistent with the complete absence of mentality; mindless bodies would function in exactly the same way, as the mind has no capacity to generate any causal impact. In short, epiphenomenalism denies that there is any mental causation. Even parallelism allows for the mind to have a measure of efficacy since mental events can, at least, cause other mental events. But under epiphenomenalism, not even this limited causal efficacy is accorded to the mind. This makes epiphenomenalism quite objectionable.

iv. Reductionism

With all the difficulties encountered by interactionism, parallelism, and epiphenomenalism, one may wonder why we don’t construe the mind in wholly physical terms – why, that is, we don’t just identify the mental with the physical. This is the idea behind reductionism. On this view, mental events just are physical events; the difference between the mental and the physical lies only in how we conceive of them, not in how they really are. Thus, there are concepts that are about mental phenomena and concepts that are about physical phenomena, but it is possible for a mental concept and a physical concept to pick out one and the same physical event.

mental-causation-fig4

As Figure 4 indicates, mental events just are physical events; there are no events that are non-physical. For this very reason, mental causation is just a species of physical causation, and is therefore no more problematic than plain old physical causation. On this view, mental causation is just physical causation that has been conceptualized using mental concepts, or described using mental vocabulary.

Objections to Reductionism: While reductionism has the virtue of presenting a clear account of mental causation, it faces the problem of justifying the reducibility of the mental to the physical. There are compelling reasons for thinking that the mind is not just a purely physical phenomenon. Descartes, for instance, gives us two arguments for the irreducibility of mental substances to physical substances. The first is the argument from divisibility, which basically claims that the mind cannot be physical, as physical things have spatial dimension but minds simply are not the kinds of things that have spatial dimension. And the second is the argument from conceivability, according to which it is conceivable that the conceiver does not have a body, but not conceivable that the conceiver does not have a mind. While contemporary philosophers no longer work within the framework of substance dualism, there are other considerations that have been used to support the irreducibility of mental properties to physical properties (for the irreducibility of phenomenal properties, see Jackson 1982, Nagel 1974, Kripke 1980, Chalmers 1996; for the irreducibility of intentional properties, see Davidson 1970, Child 1994).

2. Traditional Problems of Mental Causation

The traditional problem of mental causation begins with the idea that the mind is its own substance that has no physical characteristics. In the absence of physical characteristics, it becomes quite puzzling how the mind is supposed to exert any causal influence. There are two ways of formulating the problem: the Problem of Spatial Location and the Problem of Energy Conservation.

a. The Problem of Spatial Location

This problem is based upon a certain assumption about the nature of causation – that the cause and its effect must be spatially contiguous (touch each other, so to speak), and thus have spatial location. The spatial location requirement has ample intuitive support: a stone does not move unless something pushes against it; a pot of water does not boil unless heat is directly applied to it; a plant does not grow unless its roots draw water from the soil; and so on. (Typically, a given effect has multiple causal factors whose conjunction is necessary for the effect, and conversely, a given cause produces more than one effect. Since nothing hangs on observing this nicety, this entry will help itself to the simplifying talk of one cause per effect and one effect per cause.) In each of these cases, the causes and their effects are in spatial contact in one way or another. As a general matter, nowhere in nature is there causation where the cause or effect has no spatial location. But this is precisely what Cartesian mind-body interaction asks us to believe. The problem can be summed up by the inconsistency among the following statements:

  1. Mental causation: The mind and the body causally interact – thoughts, feelings, and perceptions, bring about bodily actions.
  2. Spatial location: Wherever there is causation, the cause and its effect must have spatial location.
  3. Dualism: The mind has no spatial location – there is no spatial location to thoughts, feelings, or perceptions.

The claim about mental causation (1) and the claim about spatial location (2) are very intuitive, so dualism would lose much credibility if it could not make sense of how the two claims could be true under dualism. However, the three claims do not look like they are consistent with each other. If causes and effects must have spatial location, as (1) maintains, then the mental cause of a bodily event must occur in a spatial location. But (2) denies that mental events have spatial location, so the assertion that there is mental causation (3) is not consistent with the conjunction of (1) and (2). Descartes’s colleagues were quite open about their puzzlement. Pierre Gassendi, for instance, asked:

How can there be effort directed at anything, or motion set up in it, unless there is mutual contact between what moves and what is moved? (Cottingham, et al., 1984, p, 236).

Princess Elizabeth of Bohemia, another contemporary of Descartes, was even more forthright about her puzzlement:

[T]he determination of movement seems always to come about from the moving body’s being propelled – to depend on the kind of impulse it gets from what sets it in motion, or again, on the nature and shape of this latter thing’s surface. Now the first two conditions involve contact, and the third involves that the impelling thing has extension; but you utterly exclude extension from your notion of soul, and contact seems to me incompatible with a thing’s being immaterial (Anscombe and Geach 1954, pp. 274 – 5).

There are two standard dualist strategies to handle the problem: the Pineal Gland Reply and the Reply from Quantum Mechanics.

Pineal Gland Reply: Descartes proposed that we could locate the workings of mental causation in the pineal gland, which Descartes believed to be the gateway between the mind and the body. We now know that the pineal gland is responsible for regulating the hormone melatonin, but aside from Descartes’ anatomical inaccuracy, the strategy of appealing to a physical locus is fundamentally misguided, because it does nothing to solve the problem. For how, one is right to ask, can mental causation occur “in” the pineal gland if the mind cannot be located “in” anything, lacking as it is in spatial dimension?

Reply from Quantum Mechanics: This reply rejects (2), the spatial location constraint upon causes and effects as inaccurate. The basis for this rejection is certain alleged findings in quantum mechanics where the position of a traveling particle, such as an electron, is indeterminate. That is, there is a chance that a particle will show up in a certain region but its presence in that region is purely a matter of chance, and yet for all its lack of a determinate spatial location, it is still capable of entering into causal relations. Perhaps minds are like this as well; they can cause things to happen even if they have no determinate location. Or so the reply goes. There are three difficulties with this reply. First, the comparison between minds and fundamental physical particles is imperfect, for electrons can have a location, albeit indeterminate, whereas minds, according to the Cartesian conception, cannot have any location at all. Second, the jury is still out on the interpretation of these alleged findings; for all we know, some theory will be able to explain away the appearance of indeterminacy and model the universe after strictly deterministic principles. And third, no entities outside of the domain of fundamental physics – macro-physical entities – have this odd indeterminacy about their occurrence or location, and so it appears too convenient to proclaim of minds, a macro-entity by any standards, that it is like the micro-physical entity of electrons in this one respect.

b. The Problem of Conservation

This problem draws upon two key assumptions. The first is the idea that causation is a matter of energy transfer, such as when one pool ball transfers its momentum to another ball upon collision, or when the calories from ingesting food get converted into bodily energy. (For energy transfer accounts of causation, see Aronson 1985, Dowe 2000, Fair 1979, and Salmon 1994.) The second is the principle of the conservation of energy, a fundamental law of nature that is taken to be a cornerstone of contemporary science. According to this principle, the total quantity of energy in the universe remains fixed at all times. Energy, of course, comes in many forms – kinetic, chemical, electrical, thermal, and so on – and energy can be transformed from one form to another, and loss or gain of energy can happen within a component part of the universe, but the sum total energy in the universe as a whole can be neither created nor destroyed. The principle of conservation entails a significant lemma, which is that the physical universe is a causally closed system: at no point in the history of the physical universe can there be outside energy causing something to happen within the system, nor can energy leave the system to cause something to happen outside of it.

Insofar as the body is a part of the physical system, it cannot be caused to move by anything other than something else within that system. But if the mind is not a part of that system, as Cartesian dualism maintains, then its causal influence upon the body would be a foreign source of energy impinging upon the energy equilibrium of the universe, thereby violating conservation. The inconsistency here is present in the following statements:

  1. Mental causation: The mind and the body causally interact; thoughts, feelings, and perceptions, bring about bodily actions.
  2. Conservation: The physical universe is a causally closed physical system: causal interactions do not increase nor decrease its sum total energy of the universe.
  3. Dualism: The mind is not a part of the causally closed physical system: mental events, such as thoughts, perceptions, and sensations, do not occur within the system.

Again, these statements cannot be true together. The conjunction of (1) and (3) entail a disruption in the balance of energy in the physical universe, but (2) denies that this can happen.

Reply from Rejection of Conservation: This reply rejects (2) by appealing to what is known as “tunneling,” a quantum mechanical phenomenon found in certain types of radioactive decay. When a particle “tunnels,” it effectively escapes a barrier that requires more energy than it could inherently have, creating a sudden surge of energy that temporarily disrupts conservation. It is as if a 10 horse-power motor put out 11 horse-power out of nowhere. The application of this possibility to dualistic mental causation is tempting: if the non-physical desire to raise one’s arm disrupts the overall energy balance when it causes one’s arm to go up, the mental event “tunnels” to our brain, thereby explaining the disruption of the sum total of energy. We certainly cannot rule out this scenario from our armchairs, but this reply is problematic, for the same reason that it was found problematic when claiming that the mind could be like electrons in having indeterminate spatial location. Tunneling is found only at the subatomic level and nowhere else in the natural world. We do not find it in biology, geology, astronomy, or in any of the other special sciences. Thus, there is no reason to expect the phenomenon of tunneling in the realm of mental events.

3. Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

a. Background to the Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

The traditional problem of mental causation lies in the commitment to substance dualism. The contemporary problem, on the other hand, lies in its commitment to property dualism, along with other assumptions concerning token physicalism, the causal efficacy of mental events versus the causal relevance of mental properties, and conditions for causal relevance.

i. Token Physicalism

Contemporary approaches to the mind typically work within the framework of physicalism, the view that everything that exists in space-time is exclusively physical or constituted by the physical. The optimal way of formulating the doctrine of physicalism is itself a substantive issue (for comprehensive discussions, see Poland 1994, Gillett and Loewer 2001, Melnyk 2003, Kim 2005), but the version that most philosophers work with, or react to, in the mental causation literature, is token physicalism (see Donald Davidson 1970). According to token physicalism, each mental event is a particular (also called a token), which is numerically identical with a physical particular; this means that a mental event is an occurrence of an event in the brain or of some other suitably complex physical medium. The converse, on the other hand is not necessarily true, since there are physical events that are not mental, such as tsunamis, apples falling to the ground, magnets attracting iron filings, and so on.

We can illustrate the concept of token identity this way. Say that Alice sneezes in such a way that the sneezing event was both a loud noise a as well as an emission of a virus b. If the loud noise was indeed one and the same event as the emission of the virus, then we can say that a is token identical with b. The token identity of a mental event and a physical event conforms to this idea: some mental occurrence was one and the same event as a physical occurrence. On Davidson’s view, an event is a mental event m just in case it has a mental property M (or it is describable in terms of mental predicates); similarly for the relevant aspects of physical events. To say, then, that a mental event m is token identical with a physical event p is to say that m and p are just one and the same thing, one event having both M and P.

Token physicalism it is to be carefully distinguished from what is known as type physicalism, the view that each mental property M is identical with, or reducible to, a physical property P. Particulars are unrepeatable (that is, they are bound to a unique spatio-temporal region) whereas types are repeatable (that is, they can show up in different things and at different times). The idea behind type physicalism can be illustrated this way. The property roundness (call it “R”) and the property circularity (“C”) are both types, as they are repeatable. As it happens, they are one and the same type, which means that any particular having R necessarily has C. The difference between token physicalism and type physicalism is basically this: whereas token physicalism only entails that every particular thing having a mental property also has some physical property or other, type physicalism entails that for each mental property, there is a physical property with which that mental property is identical.

The advantage of token physicalism is that it allows a mental event to enter into causal transactions in a way that does not violate the spatial location constraint upon causes, and therefore, does not face the Problem of Spatial Location: physical events have spatial location, so if m and p are token identical, then m has whatever spatial location p has. Nor does it run afoul of the Problem of Conservation: m just is p (and thus not distinct from p), so m‘s causal efficacy does not add anything extra over and above the causal efficacy of the event p.

ii. The Causal Efficacy of Events versus the Causal Relevance of Properties

Nonetheless, token physicalism still faces problems accounting for mental causation. While mental events are one thing, the mental properties in virtue of which those events are efficacious are another; for a single event can have many properties, but only some of them may be involved in bringing about an effect. Here is an example of this. Suppose one steps on a banana peel and falls smack down to the ground. The banana peel has many properties: its slipperiness and its yellowness, for instance. But, surely the causally relevant property was the slipperiness of the peel, not the color of the peel, for had the peel not been slippery, the falling would not have occurred (all things being equal), but the falling still would have occurred even if the peel were a different color. To track this distinction, let us use the term “efficacy” for events and “relevance” for the properties of events.

The troubling idea, then, is that while a mental event may be causally efficacious insofar as it is an event, only its physical properties, and not its mental ones, are causally relevant for bringing about the effect. An example of this is the following. Suppose Alice sneezes, causing Bob to catch her cold. Suppose also that the sneezing event was a loud noise as well as an emission of a virus. Then, while it is true to say that the loud noise caused Bob’s cold, as the loud noise is the same event as the emission of the virus, surely it was only the event’s being an emission of a virus that was causally relevant to the onset of Bob’s illness. Under token physicalism, the worry is that mental properties are like the property of being a loud noise – completely irrelevant to bringing about the effect. This is the worry that drives the contemporary problems of mental causation, which are manifest in the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion. But before introducing these problems, it will be helpful to lay out a rough account of what it means for a property to be causally relevant or irrelevant.

iii. A Test for Causal Relevance

What test can we use to determine whether a property is causally relevant or not? This is a different question from the question of what it takes for a property to pass that test. Here, we just want to lay out the test. Let us be clear that properties are causally relevant to something or other, typically, to the instantiation of other properties. Causal relevance is thus a 4-place relation where the relata consist of the cause event c, the effect event e, and properties F of c and G of e, wherein c causes e to instantiate G in virtue of the fact that c has F.

To gauge whether properties are causally relevant or irrelevant, philosophers appeal to the following conditions or counterfactuals:

Property F is causally relevant to property G only if:
  1. Suppose F and G occurred; then if F had not occurred, then G would not have occurred;
  2. Suppose F and G had not occurred; then if F had occurred, then G would have occurred;
  3. There is no H such that had H occurred without F, G would not have occurred, or had F occurred without H, G would still have occurred.

Conditions (1) – (3) convey the idea that G’s occurrence is contingent upon F’s occurrence. More specifically, (1) says that F’s occurrence is necessary for G: G doesn’t or can’t occur unless F occurs. (2) says that F’s occurrence necessitates G: F guarantees G’s occurrence. Finally, (3) says that F is not a mere spurious cause of G: F does not merely accompany the property H that happens to be the one that’s doing the real causal work. Failure to satisfy any of the three conditions would indicate that the candidate property is not causally relevant.

It is important to appreciate that these conditions are only to test for whether a property is causally relevant. As it was said earlier, they do not answer the question of what it takes for a property to pass that test. One way to put this point is to distinguish between the truth conditions for a claim and the truth makers for the claim: the truth makers of the claim describe the fact, mechanism, or elements, in virtue of which the claim is true. Thus, they do not form an analysis, certainly not a full analysis, as they are only necessary conditions that may not be jointly sufficient. A genuine analysis requires that one specify both necessary and sufficient conditions as well as what it is in virtue of which these very conditions hold – the truth-maker.

b. Three Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

In contemporary discussions of mental causation, there are three stumbling blocks for the satisfactions of the conditions for causal relevance in the case of mental properties. These are: the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion.

i. Problem of Anomalism

The basic root of the problem of anomalism is the thesis of psychophysical anomalism, the claim that there are no strict, exceptionless, laws involving mental states. The problem has been acknowledged by many philosophers, but its most explicit formulation has been laid out by Kim (Kim 1989). On a widely received view about causal relevance, a property is causally relevant only if it is “nomically subsumed,” that is, if it appears in a strict law. The denial that mental properties can appear in laws of this kind naturally threatens to render mental properties causally irrelevant. The threat of epiphenomenalism posed by the problem of anomalism can be formulated thus:

  1. Nomic Subsumption: A property can be causally relevant only if it appears in a law.
  2. Anomalism: Mental properties do not appear in laws.
    ——————————————————
  3. Epiphenomenalism: Mental properties cannot be causally relevant.

This problem of anomalism has its origin in Davidson’s theory of anomalous monism (Davidson 1970). The problem of anomalism has a bit of an ironic history since the original intent of Davidson’s anomalous monism was to explain how mental causation is possible. Nonetheless, a number of critics have argued that anomalous monism leads to epiphenomenalism (Antony 1989, Kim 1989b, 1993c, LePore and Loewer 1987, McLaughlin 1989, 1993). Anomalous monism is made up of two theses: first, that there are no laws connecting mental properties with physical properties (this is the thesis called “psychophysical anomalism”), and second, that every mental event is token-identical with a physical event, and thus causally efficacious insofar as the physical event with which it is identical is causally efficacious. It is the result of the attempt to render consistent the following seemingly inconsistent set of statements:

  1. Principle of Causal Interaction: at least some mental events interact causally with physical events.
  2. Principle of Nomic Subsumption: events related as cause and effect fall under strict deterministic laws.
  3. Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental: there are no strict deterministic laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained.

Each of these principles is independently plausible. The Principle of Causal Interaction is just the statement that mental causation occurs. The Principle of Nomic Subsumption needs a bit more explanation. This entry presents the most common reading of the principle. Suppose event c is of type F (it has F as a property) and e is of type G. According to this principle, F can be causally relevant to G only if there is a law is to the effect that events of type F cause events of type G. For instance, when a sudden sneeze causes a sleeping baby to awake, the cause has the capacity to produce that effect because there is a law-like generalization to the effect that noises above a certain level cause sleep disturbances. Davidson (1993) has objected to this construal of causation conflates causation with causal explanation. As Davidson explains, causal explanations mention properties when explaining a causal transaction, but statements reporting a causal transaction do not. When it comes to causation, events cause other events, according to Davidson, no matter how they are described – no matter which properties we refer to when talk about the events. This construal of causation has been roundly criticized (McLaughlin 1993).

The Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental states that there are no laws involving mental states that are strict, strict in the sense that they are exceptionless. A cursory look at the following generalizations reasonably backs this up:

  1. If an agent desires p and believes that doing q can bring about p, then the agent will do q.
  2. If an agent fears p, then the agent desires not-p.
  3. If an agent wants p with all her heart, but discovers that not-p, then the agent will be disappointed that not-p.

(A) – (C) represent a very small number of generalizations of folk psychology, and while they do a good job of covering many cases, we can easily imagine circumstances under which they would be false. According to the Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental, this is true of all generalizations of folk psychology.

While independently plausible, the principles together appear to generate an inconsistency: if there are no laws couched in mental terms, as is maintained by the Anomalism of the Mental, but laws are necessary for causal interaction, which is stated by the Principle of Nomic Subsumption, then it follows that mental events have no causal powers, contrary to the first statement, the Principle of Causal Interaction. Davidson resolves this inconsistency with an appeal to token physicalism (explained above), where mental events can be causally efficacious, thanks to their token-identity with causally efficacious physical events.

Token physicalism, however, is not sufficient for supporting the causal relevance of mental properties – for securing the idea that a mental event caused a physical event in virtue of its having a mental property. In fact, the very argument Davidson gives for token physicalism through his argument for anomalous monism, has been interpreted to lead to the causal irrelevance of mental properties. The interpretation goes as follows: if event c can cause event e only if there is a strict law covering c and e, and the only laws that are strict are physical laws (laws relating physical properties) it follows that c causes e because of c‘s physical properties; indeed, c cannot cause e in virtue of its mental property, because mental properties cannot come together in a law. In short, if strict laws are necessary for securing the causal relevance of properties, but there are no strict laws involving mental properties, then mental properties cannot be relevant on this view.

1. The Appeal to Ceteris Paribus Laws

 

 

Ceteris Paribus Causal Relevance: A (mental) property M of an event c is causally relevant to a (physical) property P of event e if there is a strict causal law connecting M with P or a non-strict law connecting M with P.

Problems: This solution faces three objections. The first is that the ceteris paribus clauses may threaten to render any “law” vacuous that is so modified, and so strict laws might be what we need after all (Schiffer 1991, Fodor 1991b). The second is that mental properties just may not be the kinds of properties that can appear in laws, strict or otherwise. There are two considerations that have been availed in support of this skepticism. The first is based upon claims that normative relations constitutively constrain the distribution of mental properties, a pattern then cannot also be constrained by laws (Davidson 1970, 1974; McDowell 1984; Kim 1985). The second is based upon what is called the “simulation theory of folk psychology,” the idea that mental states are attributed to an agent by placing one’s self in the agent’s situation, a process that does not require the existence of mental laws (see Heal 1995, Gordon 1995, and Goldman 1995). The third objection is that even if mental properties can appear in laws, they face the problem of exclusion, which briefly is the problem that the physical properties of an event pre-empt its mental properties, given the generality of physics – that the physical domain is completely self-sufficient in bringing about all causal transactions – and the exclusion principle, which states that a causally sufficient property of an event excludes the causal relevance of other properties of the event.

2. The Appeal to Counterfactuals

The second solution to the problem of anomalism has been pursued by LePore and Loewer 1987, 1989, and Horgan 1989. Like the appeal to ceteris paribus laws, this approach also denies that strict laws are necessary for grounding the causal relevance of a property. But instead of appealing to non-strict laws, this solution appeals to counterfactual dependencies involving mental properties.

On this view, a mental property can be causally relevant if its non-occurrence means that the effect also would not have occurred. The basic idea is this. Suppose we want to know whether one’s belief that there is water in the glass was causally relevant to the motion of reaching out for the glass. The belief is causally relevant if the motion of reaching out would not have occurred if the belief had not occurred; this is just to say that the effect is counterfactually dependent upon its cause. Here is the account given by LePore and Loewer 1987:

Counterfactual Causal Relevance: Property M of event c is causally relevant to property P of event e if:

  1. c causes e,
  2. c has M and e has P,
  3. if c did not have M, then e would not have had P,
  4. M and P are metaphysically independent.

The appeal to causation in (i) does not render this partial analysis circular, since the analysis is for causal relevance, not causation per se. Condition (ii) highlights the role of properties in causal transactions. Condition (iii) states the counterfactual relation between the properties that allegedly suffices for one’s being causally relevant to the other. Condition (iv) comes from the Humean view that logically or metaphysically connected properties cannot stand in a causal relation, and so (iv) is to ensure that M and P are candidates for causal relevance.

Problem: The main problem with this solution is that the mere holding of the relevant counterfactuals is not sufficient for causal relevance (Braun 1995; McLaughlin 1989, p. 124; Kim 2006, pp. 189 – 194). Fires give off both heat and smoke. Now, if fire is placed near a piece of wax, the wax melts because of the heat, not the smoke, given off by the fire. That is, the smoke is not causally relevant to melting the wax. However, there is a counterfactual dependency of the melting upon the smoke because smoke, as much as heat, reliably occurs when there is fire. Thus, there are spurious counterfactual dependencies, and for all we know, the counterfactual dependency of bodily motion upon mental properties is as spurious as the dependency of melting upon smoke. The lesson is this: the counterfactual dependency of G upon F does not suffice for F’s causal relevance to G. In addition, the counterfactual approach also faces the problem of exclusion.

ii. Problem of Externalism

Externalism is a thesis about semantic content; according to the thesis, we must take into consideration facts about the physical environment, as well as the linguistic norms of one’s surrounding community, when individuating contentful mental states (the classic sources are Putnam 1975, Burge 1979). This is a thesis that affects intentional states (also called propositional attitudes), the states that have representational contents, rather than phenomenal states, the states that have a “what-it-is-like” quality to them. The problem generated by externalism for the causal relevance of intentional states is that it renders the content of the intentional state extrinsic (see Fodor 1987, pp. 27 – 54; McGinn 1989, p. 118). Causation, as we intuitively understand it, however, involves only the intrinsic features of objects and events. Consequently, externalist ways of individuating intentional content make them unsuitable for causal involvement.

While it is not easy to pin down exactly the distinction between intrinsic and extrinsic properties, we can get at the general idea with the following example. Take an individual who is 6 feet tall. Being 6 feet tall does not depend upon facts in its environment; whether or not the individual is tall or short, on the other, does so depend, since whether the individual is tall, say, will depend upon whether she is among small children. Properties that do not depend upon the environment are intrinsic; those that do are extrinsic.

To appreciate how causation only involves intrinsic properties, consider the following scenario. One puts a very convincing counterfeit dollar into a soda machine, successfully allowing you to get a soda. It is natural to assume that only the intrinsic features of the dollar bill – its size, design, texture – were causally relevant to the transaction, not the fact that the dollar is genuine or counterfeit, which are extrinsic features, as they involve a relation to certain facts, namely, where it was originally produced – at the U.S. mint or in one’s garage. These latter properties are extrinsic features of the dollar and the example illustrates their causal irrelevance.

Now, when we individuate the contents of a mental state (for those mental states that have intentional contents) according to standards of externalism, the content is rendered extrinsic. The classic example is found in Putnam (1975). Consider the very familiar term, “water.” The meaning of our term “water” is H2O. Now imagine a world, “Twin Earth,” that is just like ours except that the stuff the Twin Earthlings call “water” happens to be a different chemical compound, which we can just label “XYZ.” As Putnam argues, the meaning of “water” differs between the two worlds, even if Earthlings and Twin Earthlings make all the same associations with the stuff both call “water” – that it is stuff we drink, that it falls from the sky, fills the lakes and rivers, is the universal solvent, and so on. In spite of these identical associations, the word “water” is homonymous, meaning H2O when uttered by an Earthling, but XYZ when uttered by a Twin Earthling. This point about the meaning of the word transfers over to the content of our thoughts: when an Earthling and Twin-Earthling are entertaining thoughts about what both call “water,” they are thinking about different things.

This little scenario demonstrates how content – the meaning of the intentional state – under externalism, fails to supervene upon the individual’s internal properties, and is therefore extrinsic to the agent’s body. The threat of epiphenomenalism can be formulated thus:

  1. Local Causation: A property F of an event c is causally relevant to property G of event e only if F is an intrinsic property of c.
  2. Externalism: Intentional properties are not intrinsic properties of mental events.
    ——————————————————————-
  3. Epiphenomenalism: Intentional properties are not causally relevant.

The problem is that extrinsic properties generally, as a rule, fail the test for causal relevance. As the test specified, a property can be causally relevant only if (among other things) had it failed to occur, the effect would not have occurred; and had it succeeded in occurring, then the effect would have occurred. But this pattern of counterfactual dependencies is not satisfied by externally individuated contents. Suppose you reach out for a refreshing glass of water because you believe that there is water in the glass. In order for that belief to be causally relevant, its absence must result in the absence of the reaching motion. But this isn’t what happens when we individuate content externally: the physical identical twin who is thinking about XYZ, not water proper, does exactly the same thing. Different thoughts do not manifest in different behaviors. As a result, content bearing mental states are not causally relevant to behavior.

1. The Appeal to Narrow Content (Internalism)

Solutions to the argument from externalism pursue one of two strategies; one is to deny the thesis of externalism, premise (2) (see Fodor 1980), and the other is to deny the thesis of local causation, premise (1) (see Burge 1995). Let us begin with the denial of externalism. The strategy here is to appeal to “narrow content.” Narrow content is the content that intrinsic twins have in common; narrow content, by stipulation, supervenes upon the intrinsic properties of an individual (Fodor 1991). (Think about the purely intrinsic features of the dollar bill – features that would be equally shared by a genuine bill and a counterfeit. The intrinsic features are their “narrow content.”) Unlike broad content, which is individuated in terms of the external, historical circumstances surrounding the uses of a term, narrow content is what supervenes upon the internal properties of the individuals, and is thus shared by you and your Twin-Earthly counterpart. Narrow content is the content one entertains under the Cartesian account of mental representation: as you entertain a thought of water, the content of that thought never “reaches out” beyond your head. Intentional properties, then, individuated narrowly, will be just as suited to causing behavior as any other internal properties of a person.

Problem: The appeal to narrow content certainly gets around the problem of causal irrelevance that faces broad content, but the notion of narrow content is highly contentious. Some have even argued that the notion is incoherent (see Adams et al. 1990). Consider again the counterfeit dollar. Surely we do not value it because just because it shares the same intrinsic features as the genuine article; the difference between the genuine bill and the counterfeit makes all the difference between the two. The relevance of the extrinsic is prevalent. Take a different case – the case of gold. When one wants to purchase a gold ring, one has in mind the metal with a certain molecular structure, not some alloy that looks like gold but isn’t gold. Our attributive practices honor this attention to the broad way of individuating content. When we refer to what people are thinking about, what the contents of their intentional states are, we intend to refer to the externalistically individuated contents of their mental states.

2. The Appeal to Wide Causation

The denial of the local causation thesis is the denial of the claim that only intrinsic properties of a cause can be causally relevant. The idea is that there can be “broad causation” (see Burge 1989, Yablo 1997). This view requires a little stage setting. On this approach, there is the causation of bodily motion by neural properties, on the one hand, and then there is the causation of intentionally characterized action by broadly individuated mental content. Take, for instance, one’s waving to a friend: by doing this, one performs the action of greeting a friend, but one also engages in a purely bodily process that engages one’s bones and muscles. On this solution to the problem of externalism, we have two causal processes – one that pertains to the proximal visual stimuli that result in the bodily movement – this would be “narrow causation” – and a different one that pertains to the appearance of the friend, resulting in the action of greeting – this would be “broad causation.” The friend one has in mind, of course, is the individual with whom one has had actual causal contact, not some physically similar but distinct individual (for example, an extraordinary gathering of molecular components that result in an object that looks like the friend). And to the extent that one has in mind the friend and not the freak doppelganger, one’s thought has broad content, which, on this approach, causally results in the action.

Problem: The very concept of wide causation goes against our ordinary intuitions about what causation involves. According to our ordinary intuitions, we assume that causes and their effects must be in spatial contact with each other or mediated by things that spatially link them together – that there is no action at a distance. But wide causation asks us to believe exactly this – that things are caused by situations that have no physical contact with them. It would make no difference, it seems, that it was the friend and not the doppelganger that motivated one to wave. For this reason, wide causation is not an easy solution (but see Yablo 1997 for a defense).

iii. Problem of Exclusion

It seems undeniable that mental states bring about behavior: it is because you wanted to catch the Frisbee that you sprung up to catch it – if you didn’t want to catch it, your body wouldn’t have moved the way it did. It is also undeniable that the brain, or more specifically, our neurophysiological system, is fully sufficient to bring about all bodily motion. There are many reasons, however, to think that mental states are not just mere states of the brain. But if this is the case, then it’s not clear what causal role mental states would have given that their neural correlates are fully equipped to perform all the causal work. Brain states, in other words, seem to make the mental states superfluous and therefore irrelevant.

The problem of exclusion can be laid out as follows (this formulation comes from Yablo 1992, pp. 247 – 248):

  1. Exclusion: If a property F is causally sufficient for a property G, then no property distinct from F is causally relevant to G, barring overdetermination.
  2. Closure: For every physical property P, there is a physical property P* that is causally sufficient for P.
  3. Dualism: For every mental property M, M is distinct from P*.
    —————————————————————–
  4. Epiphenomenalism: For every physical property P, there is no mental property M that is causally sufficient for P.

The exclusion problem does not subscribe to any particular views about the nature of causation and its relationship to laws. Its standard formulations just invoke certain widely held physicalist principle that the physical world is causally closed and comprehensive. The simple reference to this principle, along with the assumption that mental properties are not reducible to physical properties, are all that’s needed to set the argument in motion. In addition, its epiphenomenalist conclusion applies not just to mental properties, but to any special science property that is not strictly reducible to a physical property. The argument casts a wide net (Kim 1989b, 1992, 1993b).

The following is a menu of the main strategies that have been pursued for solving the exclusion problem (see Kim 1989a, 1990 for a discussion of some of these options):

  1. Reduction Strategy: For every mental property M, there is some physical property P with which M can be reductively identified.
  2. Supervenience Strategy: Mental properties supervene upon physical properties, and supervening properties can be causally relevant if their base properties are causally relevant.
  3. Realization Strategy: Mental properties are realized by physical properties, and mental properties are causally relevant if their realizing base properties are causally relevant.
  4. Dual Explanandum Strategy: There are different ways to explain how M and P are causally relevant.
1. Reduction Strategy

There have been several proposals along these lines, none free of problems. On one approach, each mental property M is reductively identified with a physical property P. This is the view known as the Identity Theory of Mind, which was introduced by U.T. Place in 1956 and by J.J.C. Smart in 1956. The main problem with this approach is the multiple realizability of mental properties (Fodor 1975, 1980a, 1980b; Putnam 1960). According to this thesis, there are many different physical properties P1, P2, …, Pn, each of whose instantiation can suffice for the instantiation of its corresponding mental property M. If P1 and P2 are distinct realizers of M, then M cannot be identified with both P1 and P2. This makes sense if we think of the following example. Suppose Tom and Max are not the same height. Tom is, however, of the same height as Sally. If this is the case, then Sally cannot be the same height as both Tom and Max. The upshot is that no multiply realizable mental property is identifiable with, and hence, reducible to, a physical property.

On a different approach, which attempts to accommodate the multiple realizability of mental properties, known as disjunctive reduction, M is reduced to the disjunction of all the physical property realizations (P1 or P2 or … Pn), such that generalizations of the form

M if and only if (P1 or P2 or … Pn)

hold as a matter of law. The main problem with this approach is that it is committed to disjunctive properties whose disjuncts have nothing in common at the physical level. This makes the disjunct unsuitable for appearing in laws (Armstrong 1978, 1983).

On another approach, which also attempts to accommodate the multiple realizability of mental properties, known as species-specific or “local” reduction, M is reduced to a single physical kind P relative to some species S, giving us laws of the form

S only if (M if and only if P).

The problem with this approach is that it compromises the idea that a mental property is species-invariant – that a pain, say, in a human, is the same mental property as a pain in an octopus, a Martian, or a computer (see Pereboom and Kornblith 1991).

On another approach yet, it is not mental properties that are reduced per se, but rather their instances. Property instances are known as tropes. The idea here is that we can reduce an instance of a mental property – a mental trope – with a physical trope (see Macdonald and Macdonald 1986, Robb 1997). Tropes and properties differ in an important way: while a property is repeatable – whiteness, for instance, is one and the same entity that can appear in a multitude of different objects – a trope is not repeatable. The whiteness of a piece of paper, according to a trope theorist, is a unique instance of that particular shade of whiteness. The trope strategy is to identify a mental trope with a physical trope. The idea is that since physical tropes are causally relevant, identifying a mental trope with a physical trope secures its relevance as well. However, the trope approach is only as good as the argument for the claim that a mental trope is indeed identical with a physical trope. More problematically, there is a concern that we can ask even of tropes whether a trope is causally relevant in virtue of its being a mental trope as opposed to its being a physical trope. That is, the same underlying epiphenomenalist implications that plague Davidson’s token physicalism may be raised for the trope approach.

2. Supervenience Strategy

The most developed account under this option is given by Yablo (Yablo 1993). As scarlet and crimson are each determinates of the determinable red, M and P are related as determinable to determinate. Determinables supervene upon their determinates, and do so with metaphysical necessity. That is, there is no world in which the determinable does not appear if one of its determinates is instantiated.

Yablo argues that the virtue of this approach is that it does not pit M and P against each other as competitors, “since a determinate cannot pre-empt its own determinable.” (Yablo 1992, p. 250) So just as the determinate, crimson, does not causally pre-empt its determinable, red, when we all press our brake pedals at a traffic light that’s just turned crimson, no physical property P pre-empts the determinable mental property M when an agent performs an action.

Problem: While this approach has intuitive appeal, it is not clear that a determinate does not causally exclude the determinable. Consider the determinable, being colored, which has as its determinates, redness, yellowness, and greenness. The determinable is certainly present when any of these properties is present, but different effects ensue upon the instantiation of these properties. If, for instance, a driver detected a green light, she would have continued driving, but if she had detected a red light, she would have brought her car to a full stop. It appears that the determinable, being colored, was not relevant to either outcome since it was present with opposite outcomes.

3. Realization Strategy

Shoemaker 2001 appeals to the idea of realization, as it is implicated in the theory of functionalism and its attendant notion of multiple realizability, as well as a certain account of the nature of properties in general according to which properties are causal powers. (An earlier, but less developed, strategy along these lines is suggested by Kim 1993a.) On Shoemaker’s view, both realized and realizing properties have causal powers, but the causal powers of the realized (mental) property form a subset of the causal powers of the realizing (physical) property. The benefit of this view is that a subset of causal powers cannot be “excluded” or trumped or overridden by the superset, as the subset is just a part of the superset. If a 10-pound brick crushes a statue, then the part of the brick that weighs 8 pounds will certainly be involved in the effect, and not trumped by the 10-pound brick of which it constitutes a part.

Problem: Gillett and Rives 2005 argue that this account of realization does not safeguard mental properties from causal exclusion by their realizing physical properties. The idea is that if physical properties are fundamental and do all the causal work, then no property realized by a physical property does further causal work over and above the work done by the physical realizer. Claiming that the causal powers of a realized property form a subset of its realizing base does nothing to help the realized property enter into the causal work-force.

4. Dual Explanandum Strategy

Steuber 2005 argues that causation itself cannot be separated from the explanatory schemes in which they are expressed. Since psychological explanations accomplish one thing, while physical or neurobiological explanations accomplish another, the causal relations they track are themselves different relations, and thus not in competition with one another, as there is no one explanandum for them to both explain.

A strategy of this kind has been developed by Dretske (Dretske 1988, 1989). Dretske distinguishes between a triggering cause and a structuring cause, each cause satisfying two different types of explanatory interests. Schematically speaking, if we want to know how a particular behavior came about, we seek to isolate its triggering cause; such a cause lies within the purview of neurophysiological explanations. But if we want to know why an agent performed some particular behavior and not some other type of behavior, we are seeking its structuring cause, and these are the kinds of causes that psychological explanations are particularly well suited to picking out.

Dretske illustrates the difference between a triggering cause and a structuring cause, as well as how these causes are related to each other, with the homely thermostat. A thermostat is designed to turn on the furnace when it registers a certain temperature. The triggering cause of the switching of the furnace was the cool temperature of the room, but the wiring that connects the thermostat to the furnace, for instance, is the structuring cause of the very same effect. The structuring cause, in short, is the set of pre-existing background conditions that make it possible for the triggering cause to exert its particular effect. Most designed artifacts possess this sort of bi-level causal structure, and so do we. Just as a thermostat possesses an internal sensor calibrated to turn on the furnace when the sensor registers a certain temperature, we possess an internal representational system coordinated with our motor system to trigger the appropriate bodily movements when our internal states represent the presence of certain objects in the environment. Which connections are forged between a given representational state and its corresponding bodily motion, and how these connections are made, is largely a matter of the agent’s learning history. Learning is the process during which the representational content is “recruited” as a cause of the behavior; it structures, so to speak, the relevant links between the agent’s representational states and her motor output.

Problem: Kim 1989a, however, has objected that if we insist that a bit of behavior has some causal origin that is irreducibly mental, and therefore non-physical, then this effectively violates the causal closure of the physical domain. If not, then we are back to the very problem of exclusion that Dretske’s distinction was designed to avoid.

4. Conclusion: Where We are Now

Philosophers are still busy at work trying to make sense of mental causation. Many criticize the assumptions on which the alleged problems of mental causation are predicated, particularly Kim’s formulation of the exclusion problem (Bennett 2003, Menzies 2003, Raymont 2003). Others enjoin us to accept those very positions that have been cast aside as unavailable, such as type physicalism (Hill 1991), or down-right implausible, such as epiphenomenalism (Bieri 1992, Chalmers 1996, ch.5).

Some have even questioned whether we really have a problem concerning mental causation (Baker 1993, Burge 1993). Baker 1993 has argued that once the principles of physicalism are accepted, not only are we saddled with the exclusion problem, the problem is absolutely unsolvable. But, Baker continues, the wide-scale epiphenomenalism that would ensue were we to take the principles of physicalism seriously is tantamount to a reductio ad absurdum of the principles themselves, so we must reject the principles, in which case the exclusion problem dissolves of itself. Baker quite radically proposes that we reject the causal closure thesis if we wish to hold onto the possibility of mental causation – indeed, if we want to hold onto the possibility of macro-causation generally – a possibility that Baker claims is well testified by the successes of our explanatory practices.

Antony 1991 as well as Kim 1993, however, have argued that the problem of mental causation is the problem of explaining how and why there is this explanatory success when it comes to explaining behavior in mental terms. That is, the problem does not go away by pointing out that our mentalistic explanations perform quite well. The puzzle is how they explain so well, given that the metaphysics all point to the causal irrelevance of the mental.

There are, to be sure, other novel solutions in the making. But the ideal solution, given the multiplicity of the problems surrounding mental causation – the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion – is one that can solve all the problems together, perhaps not with just one account that simultaneously solves all three, but maybe a patchwork account, each of whose components mutually support the others.

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Author Information

Julie Yoo
Email: julie.yoo@csun.edu
California State University at Northridge
U. S. A.