René Descartes (1596—1650)

René Descartes is often credited with being the “Father of Modern Philosophy.” This title is justified due both to his break with the traditional Scholastic-Aristotelian philosophy prevalent at his time and to his development and promotion of the new, mechanistic sciences. His fundamental break with Scholastic philosophy was twofold. First, Descartes thought that the Scholastics’ method was prone to doubt given their reliance on sensation as the source for all knowledge. Second, he wanted to replace their final causal model of scientific explanation with the more modern, mechanistic model.

Descartes attempted to address the former issue via his method of doubt. His basic strategy was to consider false any belief that falls prey to even the slightest doubt. This “hyperbolic doubt” then serves to clear the way for what Descartes considers to be an unprejudiced search for the truth. This clearing of his previously held beliefs then puts him at an epistemological ground-zero. From here Descartes sets out to find something that lies beyond all doubt. He eventually discovers that “I exist” is impossible to doubt and is, therefore, absolutely certain. It is from this point that Descartes proceeds to demonstrate God’s existence and that God cannot be a deceiver. This, in turn, serves to fix the certainty of everything that is clearly and distinctly understood and provides the epistemological foundation Descartes set out to find.

Once this conclusion is reached, Descartes can proceed to rebuild his system of previously dubious beliefs on this absolutely certain foundation. These beliefs, which are re-established with absolute certainty, include the existence of a world of bodies external to the mind, the dualistic distinction of the immaterial mind from the body, and his mechanistic model of physics based on the clear and distinct ideas of geometry. This points toward his second, major break with the Scholastic Aristotelian tradition in that Descartes intended to replace their system based on final causal explanations with his system based on mechanistic principles. Descartes also applied this mechanistic framework to the operation of plant, animal and human bodies, sensation and the passions. All of this eventually culminating in a moral system based on the notion of “generosity.”

The presentation below provides an overview of Descartes’ philosophical thought as it relates to these various metaphysical, epistemological, religious, moral and scientific issues, covering the wide range of his published works and correspondence.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. The Modern Turn
   1. Against Scholasticism
   2. Descartes’ Project
3. Method
4. The Mind
   1. Cogito, ergo sum
   2. The Nature of the Mind and its Ideas
5. God
   1. The Causal Arguments
   2. The Ontological Argument
6. The Epistemological Foundation
   1. Absolute Certainty and the Cartesian Circle
   2. How to Avoid Error
7. Mind-Body Relation
   1. The Real Distinction
   2. The Mind-Body Problem
8. Body and the Physical Sciences
   1. Existence of the External World
   2. The Nature of Body
   3. Physics
   4. Animal and Human Bodies
9. Sensations and Passions
10. Morality
    1. The Provisional Moral Code
    2. Generosity
11. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Life

René Descartes was born to Joachim Descartes and Jeanne Brochard on March 31, 1596 in La Haye, France near Tours. He was the youngest of the couple’s three surviving children. The oldest child, Pierre, died soon after his birth on October 19, 1589. His sister, Jeanne, was probably born sometime the following year, while his surviving older brother, also named Pierre, was born on October 19, 1591. The Descartes clan was a bourgeois family composed of mostly doctors and some lawyers. Joachim Descartes fell into this latter category and spent most of his career as a member of the provincial parliament.

After the death of their mother, which occurred soon after René’s birth, the three Descartes children were sent to their maternal grandmother, Jeanne Sain, to be raised in La Haye and remained there even after their father remarried in 1600. Not much is known about his early childhood, but René is thought to have been a sickly and fragile child, so much so that when he was sent to board at the Jesuit college at La Fleche on Easter of 1607. There, René was not obligated to rise at 5:00am with the other boys for morning prayers but was allowed to rest until 10:00am mass. At La Fleche, Descartes completed the usual courses of study in grammar and rhetoric and the philosophical curriculum with courses in the “verbal arts” of grammar, rhetoric and dialectic (or logic) and the “mathematical arts” comprised of arithmetic, music, geometry and astronomy. The course of study was capped off with courses in metaphysics, natural philosophy and ethics. Descartes is known to have disdained the impractical subjects despite having an affinity for the mathematical curriculum. But, all things considered, he did receive a very broad liberal arts education before leaving La Fleche in 1614.

Little is known of Descartes’ life from 1614-1618. But what is known is that during 1615-1616 he received a degree and a license in civil and canon law at the University of Poiters. However, some speculate that from 1614-1615 Descartes suffered a nervous breakdown in a house outside of Paris and that he lived in Paris from 1616-1618. The story picks up in the summer of 1618 when Descartes went to the Netherlands to become a volunteer for the army of Maurice of Nassau. It was during this time that he met Isaac Beekman, who was, perhaps, the most important influence on his early adulthood. It was Beekman who rekindled Descartes’ interest in science and opened his eyes to the possibility of applying mathematical techniques to other fields. As a New Year’s gift to Beekman, Descartes composed a treatise on music, which was then considered a branch of mathematics, entitled Compendium Musicae. In 1619 Descartes began serious work on mathematical and mechanical problems under Beekman’s guidance and, finally, left the service of Maurice of Nassau, planning to travel through Germany to join the army of Maximilian of Bavaria.

It is during this year (1619) that Descartes was stationed at Ulm and had three dreams that inspired him to seek a new method for scientific inquiry and to envisage a unified science. Soon afterwards, in 1620, he began looking for this new method, starting but never completing several works on method, including drafts of the first eleven rules of Rules for the Direction of the Mind. Descartes worked on and off on it for years until it was finally abandoned for good in 1628. During this time, he also worked on other, more scientifically oriented projects such as optics. In the course of these inquiries, it is possible that he discovered the law of refraction as early as 1626. It is also during this time that Descartes had regular contact with Father Marin Mersenne, who was to become his long time friend and contact with the intellectual community during his 20 years in the Netherlands.

Descartes moved to the Netherlands in late 1628 and, despite several changes of address and a few trips back to France, he remained there until moving to Sweden at the invitation of Queen Christina in late 1649. He moved to the Netherlands in order to achieve solitude and quiet that he could not attain with all the distractions of Paris and the constant intrusion of visitors. It is here in 1629 that Descartes began work on “a little treatise,” which took him approximately three years to complete, entitled The World. This work was intended to show how mechanistic physics could explain the vast array of phenomena in the world without reference to the Scholastic principles of substantial forms and real qualities, while also asserting a heliocentric conception of the solar system. But the condemnation of Galileo by the Inquisition for maintaining this latter thesis led Descartes to suppress its publication. From 1634-1636, Descartes finished his scientific essays Dioptique and Meteors, which apply his geometrical method to these fields. He also wrote a preface to these essays in the winter of 1635/1636 to be attached to them in addition to another one on geometry. This “preface” became The Discourse on Method and was published in French along with the three essays in June 1637. And, on a personal note, during this time his daughter, Francine, was born in 1635, her mother being a maid at the home where Descartes was staying. But Francine, at the age of five, died of a fever in 1640 when he was making arrangements for her to live with relatives in France so as to ensure her education.

Descartes began work on Meditations on First Philosophy in 1639. Through Mersenne, Descartes solicited criticism of his Meditations from amongst the most learned people of his day, including Antoine Arnauld, Peirre Gassendi, and Thomas Hobbes. The first edition of the Meditations was published in Latin in 1641 with six sets of objections and his replies. A second edition published in 1642 also included a seventh set of objections and replies as well as a letter to Father Dinet in which Descartes defended his system against charges of unorthodoxy. These charges were raised at the Universities of Utrecht and Leiden and stemmed from various misunderstandings about his method and the supposed opposition of his theses to Aristotle and the Christian faith.

This controversy led Descartes to post two open letters against his enemies. The first is entitled Notes on a Program posted in 1642 in which Descartes refutes the theses of his recently estranged disciple, Henricus Regius, a professor of medicine at Utrecht. These Notes were intended not only to refute what Descartes understood to be Regius’ false theses but also to distance himself from his former disciple, who had started a ruckus at Utrecht by making unorthodox claims about the nature of human beings. The second is a long attack directed at the rector of Utrecht, Gisbertus Voetius in the Open Letter to Voetiusposted in 1643. This was in response to a pamphlet anonymously circulated by some of Voetius’ friends at the University of Leiden further attacking Descartes’ philosophy. Descartes’ Open Letter led Voetius to have him summoned before the council of Utrecht, who threatened him with expulsion and the public burning of his books. Descartes, however, was able to flee to the Hague and convince the Prince of Orange to intervene on his behalf.

In the following year (1643), Descartes began an affectionate and philosophically fruitful correspondence with Princess Elizabeth of Bohemia, who was known for her acute intellect and had read the Discourse on Method. Yet, as this correspondence with Elizabeth was beginning, Descartes was already in the midst of writing a textbook version of his philosophy entitled Principles of Philosophy, which he ultimately dedicated to her. Although it was originally supposed to have six parts, he published it in 1644 with only four completed: The Principles of Human Knowledge, The Principles of Material Things, The Visible Universe, and The Earth. The other two parts were to be on plant and animal life and on human beings, but he decided it would be impossible for him to conduct all the experiments necessary for writing them. Elizabeth probed Descartes about issues that he had not dealt with in much detail before, including free will, the passions and morals. This eventually inspired Descartes to write a treatise entitled The Passions of the Soul, which was published just before his departure to Sweden in 1649. Also, during these later years, the Meditations and Principles were translated from Latin into French for a wider, more popular audience and were published in 1647.

In late 1646, Queen Christina of Sweden initiated a correspondence with Descartes through a French diplomat and friend of Descartes’ named Chanut. Christina pressed Descartes on moral issues and a discussion of the absolute good. This correspondence eventually led to an invitation for Descartes to join the Queen’s court in Stockholm in February 1649. Although he had his reservations about going, Descartes finally accepted Christina’s invitation in July of that year. He arrived in Sweden in September 1649 where he was asked to rise at 5:00am to meet the Queen to discuss philosophy, contrary to his usual habit, developed at La Fleche, of sleeping in late,. His decision to go to Sweden, however, was ill-fated, for Descartes caught pneumonia and died on February 11, 1650.

2. The Modern Turn

a. Against Scholasticism

Descartes is often called the “Father of Modern Philosophy,” implying that he provided the seed for a new philosophy that broke away from the old in important ways. This “old” philosophy is Aristotle’s as it was appropriated and interpreted throughout the later medieval period. In fact, Aristotelianism was so entrenched in the intellectual institutions of Descartes’ time that commentators argued that evidence for its the truth could be found in the Bible. Accordingly, if someone were to try to refute some main Aristotelian tenet, then he could be accused of holding a position contrary to the word of God and be punished. However, by Descartes’ time, many had come out in some way against one Scholastic-Aristotelian thesis or other. So, when Descartes argued for the implementation of his modern system of philosophy, breaks with the Scholastic tradition were not unprecedented.

Descartes broke with this tradition in at least two fundamental ways. The first was his rejection of substantial forms as explanatory principles in physics. A substantial form was thought to be an immaterial principle of material organization that resulted in a particular thing of a certain kind. The main principle of substantial forms was the final cause or purpose of being that kind of thing. For example, the bird called the swallow. The substantial form of “swallowness” unites with matter so as to organize it for the sake of being a swallow kind of thing. This also means that any dispositions or faculties the swallow has by virtue of being that kind of thing is ultimately explained by the goal or final cause of being a swallow. So, for instance, the goal of being a swallow is the cause of the swallow’s ability to fly. Hence, on this account, a swallow flies for the sake of being a swallow. Although this might be true, it does not say anything new or useful about swallows, and so it seemed to Descartes that Scholastic philosophy and science was incapable of discovering any new or useful knowledge.

Descartes rejected the use of substantial forms and their concomitant final causes in physics precisely for this reason. Indeed, his essay Meteorology, that appeared alongside the Discourse on Method, was intended to show that clearer and more fruitful explanations can be obtained without reference to substantial forms but only by way of deductions from the configuration and motion of parts. Hence, his point was to show that mechanistic principles are better suited for making progress in the physical sciences. Another reason Descartes rejected substantial forms and final causes in physics was his belief that these notions were the result of the confusion of the idea of the body with that of the mind. In the Sixth Replies, Descartes uses the Scholastic conception of gravity in a stone, to make his point. On this account, a characteristic goal of being a stone was a tendency to move toward the center of the earth. This explanation implies that the stone has knowledge of this goal, of the center of the earth and of how to get there. But how can a stone know anything, since it does not think? So, it is a mistake to ascribe mental properties like knowledge to entirely physical things. This mistake should be avoided by clearly distinguishing the idea of the mind from the idea of the body. Descartes considered himself to be the first to do this. His expulsion of the metaphysical principles of substantial forms and final causes helped clear the way for Descartes’ new metaphysical principles on which his modern, mechanistic physics was based.

The second fundamental point of difference Descartes had with the Scholastics was his denial of the thesis that all knowledge must come from sensation. The Scholastics were devoted to the Aristotelian tenet that everyone is born with a clean slate, and that all material for intellectual understanding must be provided through sensation. Descartes, however, argued that since the senses sometimes deceive, they cannot be a reliable source for knowledge. Furthermore, the truth of propositions based on sensation is naturally probabilistic and the propositions, therefore, are doubtful premises when used in arguments. Descartes was deeply dissatisfied with such uncertain knowledge. He then replaced the uncertain premises derived from sensation with the absolute certainty of the clear and distinct ideas perceived by the mind alone, as will be explained below.

b. Descartes’ Project

In the preface to the French edition of the Principles of Philosophy, Descartes uses a tree as a metaphor for his holistic view of philosophy. “The roots are metaphysics, the trunk is physics, and the branches emerging from the trunk are all the other sciences, which may be reduced to three principal ones, namely medicine, mechanics and morals” (AT IXB 14: CSM I 186). Although Descartes does not expand much more on this image, a few other insights into his overall project can be discerned. First, notice that metaphysics constitutes the roots securing the rest of the tree. For it is in Descartes’ metaphysics where an absolutely certain and secure epistemological foundation is discovered. This, in turn, grounds knowledge of the geometrical properties of bodies, which is the basis for his physics. Second, physics constitutes the trunk of the tree, which grows up directly from the roots and provides the basis for the rest of the sciences. Third, the sciences of medicine, mechanics and morals grow out of the trunk of physics, which implies that these other sciences are just applications of his mechanistic science to particular subject areas. Finally, the fruits of the philosophy tree are mainly found on these three branches, which are the sciences most useful and beneficial to humankind. However, an endeavor this grand cannot be conducted haphazardly but should be carried out in an orderly and systematic way. Hence, before even attempting to plant this tree, Descartes must first figure out a method for doing so.

3. Method

Aristotle and subsequent medieval dialecticians set out a fairly large, though limited, set of acceptable argument forms known as “syllogisms” composed of a general or major premise, a particular or minor premise and a conclusion. Although Descartes recognized that these syllogistic forms preserve truth from premises to conclusion such that if the premises are true, then the conclusion must be true, he still found them faulty. First, these premises are supposed to be known when, in fact, they are merely believed, since they express only probabilities based on sensation. Accordingly, conclusions derived from merely probable premises can only be probable themselves, and, therefore, these probable syllogisms serve more to increase doubt rather than knowledge Moreover, the employment of this method by those steeped in the Scholastic tradition had led to such subtle conjectures and plausible arguments that counter-arguments were easily constructed, leading to profound confusion. As a result, the Scholastic tradition had become such a confusing web of arguments, counter-arguments and subtle distinctions that the truth often got lost in the cracks. (Rules for the Direction of the Mind, AT X 364, 405-406 & 430: CSM I 11-12, 36 & 51-52).

Descartes sought to avoid these difficulties through the clarity and absolute certainty of geometrical-style demonstration. In geometry, theorems are deduced from a set of self-evident axioms and universally agreed upon definitions. Accordingly, direct apprehension of clear, simple and indubitable truths (or axioms) by intuition and deductions from those truths can lead to new and indubitable knowledge. Descartes found this promising for several reasons. First, the ideas of geometry are clear and distinct, and therefore they are easily understood unlike the confused and obscure ideas of sensation. Second, the propositions constituting geometrical demonstrations are not probabilistic conjectures but are absolutely certain so as to be immune from doubt. This has the additional advantage that any proposition derived from some one or combination of these absolutely certain truths will itself be absolutely certain. Hence, geometry’s rules of inference preserve absolutely certain truth from simple, indubitable and intuitively grasped axioms to their deductive consequences unlike the probable syllogisms of the Scholastics.

The choice of geometrical method was obvious for Descartes given his previous success in applying this method to other disciplines like optics. Yet his application of this method to philosophy was not unproblematic due to a revival of ancient arguments for global or radical skepticism based on the doubtfulness of human reasoning. But Descartes wanted to show that truths both intuitively grasped and deduced are beyond this possibility of doubt. His tactic was to show that, despite the best skeptical arguments, there is at least one intuitive truth that is beyond all doubt and from which the rest of human knowledge can be deduced. This is precisely the project of Descartes’ seminal work, Meditations on First Philosophy.

In the First Meditation, Descartes lays out several arguments for doubting all of his previously held beliefs. He first observes that the senses sometimes deceive, for example, objects at a distance appear to be quite small, and surely it is not prudent to trust someone (or something) that has deceived us even once. However, although this may apply to sensations derived under certain circumstances, doesn’t it seem certain that “I am here, sitting by the fire, wearing a winter dressing gown, holding this piece of paper in my hands, and so on”? (AT VII 18: CSM II 13). Descartes’ point is that even though the senses deceive us some of the time, what basis for doubt exists for the immediate belief that, for example, you are reading this article? But maybe the belief of reading this article or of sitting by the fireplace is not based on true sensations at all but on the false sensations found in dreams. If such sensations are just dreams, then it is not really the case that you are reading this article but in fact you are in bed asleep. Since there is no principled way of distinguishing waking life from dreams, any belief based on sensation has been shown to be doubtful. This includes not only the mundane beliefs about reading articles or sitting by the fire but even the beliefs of experimental science are doubtful, because the observations upon which they are based may not be true but mere dream images. Therefore, all beliefs based on sensation have been called into doubt, because it might all be a dream.

This, however, does not pertain to mathematical beliefs, since they are not based on sensation but on reason. For even though one is dreaming, for example, that, 2 + 3 = 5, the certainty of this proposition is not called into doubt, because 2 + 3 = 5 whether the one believing it is awake or dreaming. Descartes continues to wonder about whether or not God could make him believe there is an earth, sky and other extended things when, in fact, these things do not exist at all. In fact, people sometimes make mistakes about things they think are most certain such as mathematical calculations. But maybe people are not mistaken just some of the time but all of the time such that believing that 2 + 3 = 5 is some kind of persistent and collective mistake, and so the sum of 2 + 3 is really something other than 5. However, such universal deception seems inconsistent with God’s supreme goodness. Indeed, even the occasional deception of mathematical miscalculation also seems inconsistent with God’s goodness, yet people do sometimes make mistakes. Then, in line with the skeptics, Descartes supposes, for the sake of his method, that God does not exist, but instead there is an evil demon with supreme power and cunning that puts all his efforts into deceiving him so that he is always mistaken about everything, including mathematics.

In this way, Descartes called all of his previous beliefs into doubt through some of the best skeptical arguments of his day But he was still not satisfied and decided to go a step further by considering false any belief that falls prey to even the slightest doubt. So, by the end of the First Meditation, Descartes finds himself in a whirlpool of false beliefs. However, it is important to realize that these doubts and the supposed falsehood of all his beliefs are for the sake of his method: he does not really believe that he is dreaming or is being deceived by an evil demon; he recognizes that his doubt is merely hyperbolic. But the point of this “methodological” or ‘hyperbolic” doubt is to clear the mind of preconceived opinions that might obscure the truth. The goal then is to find something that cannot be doubted even though an evil demon is deceiving him and even though he is dreaming. This first indubitable truth will then serve as an intuitively grasped metaphysical “axiom” from which absolutely certain knowledge can be deduced. For more, see Cartesian skepticism.

4. The Mind

a. Cogito, ergo sum

In the Second Meditation, Descartes tries to establish absolute certainty in his famous reasoning: Cogito, ergo sum or “I think, therefore I am.” These Meditations are conducted from the first person perspective, from Descartes.’ However, he expects his reader to meditate along with him to see how his conclusions were reached. This is especially important in the Second Meditation where the intuitively grasped truth of “I exist” occurs. So the discussion here of this truth will take place from the first person or “I” perspective. All sensory beliefs had been found doubtful in the previous meditation, and therefore all such beliefs are now considered false. This includes the belief that I have a body endowed with sense organs. But does the supposed falsehood of this belief mean that I do not exist? No, for if I convinced myself that my beliefs are false, then surely there must be an “I” that was convinced. Moreover, even if I am being deceived by an evil demon, I must exist in order to be deceived at all. So “I must finally conclude that the proposition, ‘I am,’ ‘I exist,’ is necessarily true whenever it is put forward by me or conceived in my mind” (AT VII 25: CSM II 16-17). This just means that the mere fact that I am thinking, regardless of whether or not what I am thinking is true or false, implies that there must be something engaged in that activity, namely an “I.” Hence, “I exist” is an indubitable and, therefore, absolutely certain belief that serves as an axiom from which other, absolutely certain truths can be deduced.

b. The Nature of the Mind and its Ideas

The Second Meditation continues with Descartes asking, “What am I?” After discarding the traditional Scholastic-Aristotelian concept of a human being as a rational animal due to the inherent difficulties of defining “rational” and “animal,” he finally concludes that he is a thinking thing, a mind: “A thing that doubts, understands, affirms, denies, is willing, is unwilling, and also imagines and has sense perceptions” (AT VII 28: CSM II 19). In the Principles, part I, sections 32 and 48, Descartes distinguishes intellectual perception and volition as what properly belongs to the nature of the mind alone while imagination and sensation are, in some sense, faculties of the mind insofar as it is united with a body. So imagination and sensation are faculties of the mind in a weaker sense than intellect and will, since they require a body in order to perform their functions. Finally, in the Sixth Meditation, Descartes claims that the mind or “I” is a non-extended thing. Now, since extension is the nature of body, is a necessary feature of body, it follows that the mind is by its nature not a body but an immaterial thing. Therefore, what I am is an immaterial thinking thing with the faculties of intellect and will.

It is also important to notice that the mind is a substance and the modes of a thinking substance are its ideas. For Descartes a substance is a thing requiring nothing else in order to exist. Strictly speaking, this applies only to God whose existence is his essence, but the term “substance” can be applied to creatures in a qualified sense. Minds are substances in that they require nothing except God’s concurrence, in order to exist. But ideas are “modes” or “ways” of thinking, and, therefore, modes are not substances, since they must be the ideas of some mind or other. So, ideas require, in addition to God’s concurrence, some created thinking substance in order to exist (see Principles of Philosophy, part I, sections 51 & 52). Hence the mind is an immaterial thinking substance, while its ideas are its modes or ways of thinking.

Descartes continues on to distinguish three kinds of ideas at the beginning of the Third Meditation, namely those that are fabricated, adventitious, or innate. Fabricated ideas are mere inventions of the mind. Accordingly, the mind can control them so that they can be examined and set aside at will and their internal content can be changed. Adventitious ideas are sensations produced by some material thing existing externally to the mind. But, unlike fabrications, adventitious ideas cannot be examined and set aside at will nor can their internal content be manipulated by the mind. For example, no matter how hard one tries, if someone is standing next to a fire, she cannot help but feel the heat as heat. She cannot set aside the sensory idea of heat by merely willing it as we can do with our idea of Santa Claus, for example. She also cannot change its internal content so as to feel something other than heat–say, cold. Finally, innate ideas are placed in the mind by God at creation. These ideas can be examined and set aside at will but their internal content cannot be manipulated. Geometrical ideas are paradigm examples of innate ideas. For example, the idea of a triangle can be examined and set aside at will, but its internal content cannot be manipulated so as to cease being the idea of a three-sided figure. Other examples of innate ideas would be metaphysical principles like “what is done cannot be undone,” the idea of the mind, and the idea of God.

Descartes’ idea of God will be discussed momentarily, but let’s consider his claim that the mind is better known than the body. This is the main point of the wax example found in the Second Meditation. Here, Descartes pauses from his methodological doubt to examine a particular piece of wax fresh from the honeycomb:

It has not yet quite lost the taste of the honey; it retains some of the scent of flowers from which it was gathered; its color shape and size are plain to see; it is hard, cold and can be handled without difficulty; if you rap it with your knuckle it makes a sound. (AT VII 30: CSM II 20)

The point is that the senses perceive certain qualities of the wax like its hardness, smell, and so forth. But, as it is moved closer to the fire, all of these sensible qualities change. “Look: the residual taste is eliminated, the smell goes away, the color changes, the shape is lost, the size increases, it becomes liquid and hot” (AT VII 30: CSM II 20). However, despite these changes in what the senses perceive of the wax, it is still judged to be the same wax now as before. To warrant this judgment, something that does not change must have been perceived in the wax.

This reasoning establishes at least three important points. First, all sensation involves some sort of judgment, which is a mental mode. Accordingly, every sensation is, in some sense, a mental mode, and “the more attributes [that is, modes] we discover in the same thing or substance, the clearer is our knowledge of that substance” (AT VIIIA 8: CSM I 196). Based on this principle, the mind is better known than the body, because it has ideas about both extended and mental things and not just of extended things, and so it has discovered more modes in itself than in bodily substances. Second, this is also supposed to show that what is unchangeable in the wax is its extension in length, breadth and depth, which is not perceivable by the senses but by the mind alone. The shape and size of the wax are modes of this extension and can, therefore, change. But the extension constituting this wax remains the same and permits the judgment that the body with the modes existing in it after being moved by the fire is the same body as before even though all of its sensible qualities have changed. One final lesson is that Descartes is attempting to wean his reader from reliance on sense images as a source for, or an aid to, knowledge. Instead, people should become accustomed to thinking without images in order to clearly understand things not readily or accurately represented by them, for example, God and the mind. So, according to Descartes, immaterial, mental things are better known and, therefore, are better sources of knowledge than extended things.

5. God

a. The Causal Arguments

At the beginning of the Third Meditation only “I exist” and “I am a thinking thing” are beyond doubt and are, therefore, absolutely certain. From these intuitively grasped, absolutely certain truths, Descartes now goes on to deduce the existence of something other than himself, namely God. Descartes begins by considering what is necessary for something to be the adequate cause of its effect. This will be called the “Causal Adequacy Principle” and is expressed as follows: “there must be at least as much reality in the efficient and total cause as in the effect of that cause,” which in turn implies that something cannot come from nothing (AT VII 40: CSM II 28). Here Descartes is espousing a causal theory that implies whatever is possessed by an effect must have been given to it by its cause. For example, when a pot of water is heated to a boil, it must have received that heat from some cause that had at least that much heat. Moreover, something that is not hot enough cannot cause water to boil, because it does not have the requisite reality to bring about that effect. In other words, something cannot give what it does not have.

Descartes goes on to apply this principle to the cause of his ideas. This version of the Causal Adequacy Principle states that whatever is contained objectively in an idea must be contained either formally or eminently in the cause of that idea. Definitions of some key terms are now in order. First, the objective reality contained in an idea is just its representational content; in other words, it is the “object” of the idea or what that idea is about. The idea of the sun, for instance, contains the reality of the sun in it objectively. Second, the formal reality contained in something is a reality actually contained in that thing. For example, the sun itself has the formal reality of extension since it is actually an extended thing or body. Finally, a reality is contained in something eminently when that reality is contained in it in a higher form such that (1) the thing does not possess that reality formally, but (2) it has the ability to cause that reality formally in something else. For example, God is not formally an extended thing but solely a thinking thing; however, he is eminently the extended universe in that it exists in him in a higher form, and accordingly he has the ability to cause its existence. The main point is that the Causal Adequacy Principle also pertains to the causes of ideas so that, for instance, the idea of the sun must be caused by something that contains the reality of the sun either actually (formally) or in some higher form (eminently).

Once this principle is established, Descartes looks for an idea of which he could not be the cause. Based on this principle, he can be the cause of the objective reality of any idea that he has either formally or eminently. He is formally a finite substance, and so he can be the cause of any idea with the objective reality of a finite substance. Moreover, since finite substances require only God’s concurrence to exist and modes require a finite substance and God, finite substances are more real than modes. Accordingly, a finite substance is not formally but eminently a mode, and so he can be the cause of all his ideas of modes. But the idea of God is the idea of an infinite substance. Since a finite substance is less real than an infinite substance by virtue of the latter’s absolute independence, it follows that Descartes, a finite substance, cannot be the cause of his idea of an infinite substance. This is because a finite substance does not have enough reality to be the cause of this idea, for if a finite substance were the cause of this idea, then where would it have gotten the extra reality? But the idea must have come from something. So something that is actually an infinite substance, namely God, must be the cause of the idea of an infinite substance. Therefore, God exists as the only possible cause of this idea.

Notice that in this argument Descartes makes a direct inference from having the idea of an infinite substance to the actual existence of God. He provides another argument that is cosmological in nature in response to a possible objection to this first argument. This objection is that the cause of a finite substance with the idea of God could also be a finite substance with the idea of God. Yet what was the cause of that finite substance with the idea of God? Well, another finite substance with the idea of God. But what was the cause of that finite substance with the idea of God? Well, another finite substance . . . and so on to infinity. Eventually an ultimate cause of the idea of God must be reached in order to provide an adequate explanation of its existence in the first place and thereby stop the infinite regress. That ultimate cause must be God, because only he has enough reality to cause it. So, in the end, Descartes claims to have deduced God’s existence from the intuitions of his own existence as a finite substance with the idea of God and the Causal Adequacy Principle, which is “manifest by the natural light,” thereby indicating that it is supposed to be an absolutely certain intuition as well.

b. The Ontological Argument

The ontological argument is found in the Fifth Meditation and follows a more straightforwardly geometrical line of reasoning. Here Descartes argues that God’s existence is deducible from the idea of his nature just as the fact that the sum of the interior angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles is deducible from the idea of the nature of a triangle. The point is that this property is contained in the nature of a triangle, and so it is inseparable from that nature. Accordingly, the nature of a triangle without this property is unintelligible. Similarly, it is apparent that the idea of God is that of a supremely perfect being, that is, a being with all perfections to the highest degree. Moreover, actual existence is a perfection, at least insofar as most would agree that it is better to actually exist than not. Now, if the idea of God did not contain actual existence, then it would lack a perfection. Accordingly, it would no longer be the idea of a supremely perfect being but the idea of something with an imperfection, namely non-existence, and, therefore, it would no longer be the idea of God. Hence, the idea of a supremely perfect being or God without existence is unintelligible. This means that existence is contained in the essence of an infinite substance, and therefore God must exist by his very nature. Indeed, any attempt to conceive of God as not existing would be like trying to conceive of a mountain without a valley – it just cannot be done.

6. The Epistemological Foundation

a. Absolute Certainty and the Cartesian Circle

Recall that in the First Meditation Descartes supposed that an evil demon was deceiving him. So as long as this supposition remains in place, there is no hope of gaining any absolutely certain knowledge. But he was able to demonstrate God’s existence from intuitively grasped premises, thereby providing, a glimmer of hope of extricating himself from the evil demon scenario. The next step is to demonstrate that God cannot be a deceiver. At the beginning of the Fourth Meditation, Descartes claims that the will to deceive is “undoubtedly evidence of malice or weakness” so as to be an imperfection. But, since God has all perfections and no imperfections, it follows that God cannot be a deceiver. For to conceive of God with the will to deceive would be to conceive him to be both having no imperfections and having one imperfection, which is impossible; it would be like trying to conceive of a mountain without a valley. This conclusion, in addition to God’s existence, provides the absolutely certain foundation Descartes was seeking from the outset of the Meditations. It is absolutely certain because both conclusions (namely that God exists and that God cannot be a deceiver) have themselves been demonstrated from immediately grasped and absolutely certain intuitive truths.

This means that God cannot be the cause of human error, since he did not create humans with a faculty for generating them, nor could God create some being, like an evil demon, who is bent on deception. Rather, humans are the cause of their own errors when they do not use their faculty of judgment correctly. Second, God’s non-deceiving nature also serves to guarantee the truth of all clear and distinct ideas. So God would be a deceiver, if there were a clear and distinct idea that was false, since the mind cannot help but believe them to be true. Hence, clear and distinct ideas must be true on pain of contradiction. This also implies that knowledge of God’s existence is required for having any absolutely certain knowledge. Accordingly, atheists, who are ignorant of God’s existence, cannot have absolutely certain knowledge of any kind, including scientific knowledge.

But this veridical guarantee gives rise to a serious problem within the Meditations, stemming from the claim that all clear and distinct ideas are ultimately guaranteed by God’s existence, which is not established until the Third Meditation. This means that those truths reached in the Second Meditation, such as “I exist” and “I am a thinking thing,” and those principles used in the Third Meditation to conclude that God exists, are not clearly and distinctly understood, and so they cannot be absolutely certain. Hence, since the premises of the argument for God’s existence are not absolutely certain, the conclusion that God exists cannot be certain either. This is what is known as the “Cartesian Circle,” because Descartes’ reasoning seems to go in a circle in that he needs God’s existence for the absolute certainty of the earlier truths and yet he needs the absolute certainty of these earlier truths to demonstrate God’s existence with absolute certainty.

Descartes’ response to this concern is found in the Second Replies. There he argues that God’s veridical guarantee only pertains to the recollection of arguments and not the immediate awaRenéss of an argument’s clarity and distinctness currently under consideration. Hence, those truths reached before the demonstration of God’s existence are clear and distinct when they are being attended to but cannot be relied upon as absolutely certain when those arguments are recalled later on. But once God’s existence has been demonstrated, the recollection of the clear and distinct perception of the premises is sufficient for absolutely certain and, therefore, perfect knowledge of its conclusion (see also the Fifth Meditation at AT VII 69-70: CSM II XXX).

b. How to Avoid Error

In the Third Meditation, Descartes argues that only those ideas called “judgments” can, strictly speaking, be true or false, because it is only in making a judgment that the resemblance, conformity or correspondence of the idea to things themselves is affirmed or denied. So if one affirms that an idea corresponds to a thing itself when it really does not, then an error has occurred. This faculty of judging is described in more detail in the Fourth Meditation. Here judgment is described as a faculty of the mind resulting from the interaction of the faculties of intellect and will. Here Descartes observes that the intellect is finite in that humans do not know everything, and so their understanding of things is limited. But the will or faculty of choice is seemingly infinite in that it can be applied to just about anything whatsoever. The finitude of the intellect along with this seeming infinitude of the will is the source of human error. For errors arise when the will exceeds the understanding such that something laying beyond the limits of the understanding is voluntarily affirmed or denied. To put it more simply: people make mistakes when they choose to pass judgment on things they do not fully understand. So the will should be restrained within the bounds of what the mind understands in order to avoid error. Indeed, Descartes maintains that judgments should only be made about things that are clearly and distinctly understood, since their truth is guaranteed by God’s non-deceiving nature. If one only makes judgments about what is clearly and distinctly understood and abstains from making judgments about things that are not, then error would be avoided altogether. In fact, it would be impossible to go wrong if this rule were unwaveringly followed.

7. Mind-Body Relation

a. The Real Distinction

One of Descartes’ main conclusions is that the mind is really distinct from the body. But what is a “real distinction”? Descartes explains it best at Principles, part 1, section 60. Here he first states that it is a distinction between two or more substances. Second, a real distinction is perceived when one substance can be clearly and distinctly understood without the other and vice versa. Third, this clear and distinct understanding shows that God can bring about anything understood in this way. Hence, in arguing for the real distinction between mind and body, Descartes is arguing that 1) the mind is a substance, 2) it can be clearly and distinctly understood without any other substance, including bodies, and 3) that God could create a mental substance all by itself without any other created substance. So Descartes is ultimately arguing for the possibility of minds or souls existing without bodies.

Descartes argues that mind and body are really distinct in two places in the Sixth Meditation. The first argument is that he has a clear and distinct understanding of the mind as a thinking, non-extended thing and of the body as an extended, non-thinking thing. So these respective ideas are clearly and distinctly understood to be opposite from one another and, therefore, each can be understood all by itself without the other. Two points should be mentioned here. First, Descartes’ claim that these perceptions are clear and distinct indicates that the mind cannot help but believe them true, and so they must be true for otherwise God would be a deceiver, which is impossible. So the premises of this argument are firmly rooted in his foundation for absolutely certain knowledge. Second, this indicates further that he knows that God can create mind and body in the way that they are being clearly and distinctly understood. Therefore, the mind can exist without the body and vice versa.

The second version is found later in the Sixth Meditation where Descartes claims to understand the nature of body or extension to be divisible into parts, while the nature of the mind is understood to be “something quite simple and complete” so as not to be composed of parts and is, therefore, indivisible. From this it follows that mind and body cannot have the same nature, for if this were true, then the same thing would be both divisible and not divisible, which is impossible. Hence, mind and body must have two completely different natures in order for each to be able to be understood all by itself without the other. Although Descartes does not make the further inference here to the conclusion that mind and body are two really distinct substances, it nevertheless follows from their respective abilities to be clearly and distinctly understood without each other that God could create one without the other.

b. The Mind-Body Problem

The famous mind-body problem has its origins in Descartes’ conclusion that mind and body are really distinct. The crux of the difficulty lies in the claim that the respective natures of mind and body are completely different and, in some way, opposite from one another. On this account, the mind is an entirely immaterial thing without any extension in it whatsoever; and, conversely, the body is an entirely material thing without any thinking in it at all. This also means that each substance can have only its kind of modes. For instance, the mind can only have modes of understanding, will and, in some sense, sensation, while the body can only have modes of size, shape, motion, and quantity. But bodies cannot have modes of understanding or willing, since these are not ways of being extended; and minds cannot have modes of shape or motion, since these are not ways of thinking.

The difficulty arises when it is noticed that sometimes the will moves the body, for example, the intention to ask a question in class causes the raising of your arm, and certain motions in the body cause the mind to have sensations. But how can two substances with completely different natures causally interact? Pierre Gassendi in the Fifth Objections and Princess Elizabeth in her correspondence with Descartes both noted this problem and explained it in terms of contact and motion. The main thrust of their concern is that the mind must be able to come into contact with the body in order to cause it to move. Yet contact must occur between two or more surfaces, and, since having a surface is a mode of extension, minds cannot have surfaces. Therefore, minds cannot come into contact with bodies in order to cause some of their limbs to move. Furthermore, although Gassendi and Elizabeth were concerned with how a mental substance can cause motion in a bodily substance, a similar problem can be found going the other way: how can the motion of particles in the eye, for example, traveling through the optic nerve to the brain cause visual sensations in the mind, if no contact or transfer of motion is possible between the two?

This could be a serious problem for Descartes, because the actual existence of modes of sensation and voluntary bodily movement indicates that mind and body do causally interact. But the completely different natures of mind and body seem to preclude the possibility of this interaction. Hence, if this problem cannot be resolved, then it could be used to imply that mind and body are not completely different but they must have something in common in order to facilitate this interaction. Given Elizabeth’s and Gassendi’s concerns, it would suggest that the mind is an extended thing capable of having a surface and motion. Therefore, Descartes could not really come to a clear and distinct understanding of mind and body independently of one another, because the nature of the mind would have to include extension or body in it.

Descartes, however, never seemed very concerned about this problem. The reason for this lack of concern is his conviction expressed to both Gassendi and Elizabeth that the problem rests upon a misunderstanding about the union between mind and body. Though he does not elaborate to Gassendi, Descartes does provide some insight in a 21 May 1643 letter to Elizabeth. In that letter, Descartes distinguishes between various primitive notions. The first is the notion of the body, which entails the notions of shape and motion. The second is the notion of the mind or soul, which includes the perceptions of the intellect and the inclinations of the will. The third is the notion of the union of the soul with the body, on which depend the notion of the soul’s power to move the body and the body’s power to cause sensations and passions in the soul.

The notions entailed by or included in the primitive notions of body and soul just are the notions of their respective modes. This suggests that the notions depending on the primitive notion of the union of soul and body are the modes of the entity resulting from this union. This would also mean that a human being is one thing instead of two things that causally interact through contact and motion as Elizabeth and Gassendi supposed. Instead, a human being, that is, a soul united with a body, would be a whole that is more than the sum of its parts. Accordingly, the mind or soul is a part with its own capacity for modes of intellect and will; the body is a part with its own capacity for modes of size, shape, motion and quantity; and the union of mind and body or human being, has a capacity for its own set of modes over and above the capacities possessed by the parts alone. On this account, modes of voluntary bodily movement would not be modes of the body alone resulting from its mechanistic causal interaction with a mental substance, but rather they would be modes of the whole human being. The explanation of, for example, raising the arm would be found in a principle of choice internal to human nature and similarly sensations would be modes of the whole human being. Hence, the human being would be causing itself to move and would have sensations and, therefore, the problem of causal interaction between mind and body is avoided altogether. Finally, on the account sketched here, Descartes’ human being is actually one, whole thing, while mind and body are its parts that God could make exist independently of one another.

However, a final point should be made before closing this section. The position sketched in the previous couple of paragraphs is not the prevalent view among scholars and requires more justification than can be provided here. Most scholars understand Descartes’ doctrine of the real distinction between mind and body in much the same way as Elizabeth and Gassendi did such that Descartes’ human being is believed to be not one, whole thing but two substances that somehow mechanistically interact. This also means that they find the mind-body problem to be a serious, if not fatal, flaw of Descartes’ entire philosophy. But the benefit of the brief account provided here is that it helps explain Descartes’ lack of concern for this issue and his persistent claims that an understanding of the union of mind and body would put to rest people’s concerns about causal interaction via contact and motion.

8. Body and the Physical Sciences

a. Existence of the External World

In the Sixth Meditation, Descartes recognizes that sensation is a passive faculty that receives sensory ideas from something else. But what is this “something else”? According to the Causal Adequacy Principle of the Third Meditation, this cause must have at least as much reality either formally or eminently as is contained objectively in the produced sensory idea. It, therefore, must be either Descartes himself, a body or extended thing that actually has what is contained objectively in the sensory idea, or God or some creature more noble than a body, who would possess that reality eminently. It cannot be Descartes, since he has no control over these ideas. It cannot be God or some other creature more noble than a body, for if this were so, then God would be a deceiver, because the very strong inclination to believe that bodies are the cause of sensory ideas would then be wrong; and if it is wrong, there is no faculty that could discover the error. Accordingly, God would be the source of the mistake and not human beings, which means that he would be a deceiver. So bodies must be the cause of the ideas of them, and therefore bodies exist externally to the mind.

b. The Nature of Body

In part II of the Principles, Descartes argues that the entire physical universe is corporeal substance indefinitely extended in length, breadth, and depth. This means that the extension constituting bodies and the extension constituting the space in which those bodies are said to be located are the same. Here Descartes is rejecting the claim held by some that bodies have something over and above extension as part of their nature, namely impenetrability, while space is just penetrable extension in which impenetrable bodies are located. Therefore, body and space have the same extension in that body is not impenetrable extension and space penetrable extension, but rather there is only one kind of extension. Descartes maintains further that extension entails impenetrability, and hence there is only impenetrable extension. He goes on to state that: “The terms ‘place’ and ‘space,’ then, do not signify anything different from the body which is said to be in a place . . .” (AT VIIIA 47: CSM I 228). Hence, it is not that bodies are in space but that the extended universe is composed of a plurality or plenum of impenetrable bodies. On this account, there is no place in which a particular body is located, but rather what is called a “place” is just a particular body’s relation to other bodies. However, when a body is said to change its place, it merely has changed its relation to these other bodies, but it does not leave an “empty” space behind to be filled by another body. Rather, another body takes the place of the first such that a new part of extension now constitutes that place or space.

Here an example should prove helpful. Consider the example of a full wine bottle. The wine is said to occupy that place within the bottle. Once the wine is finished, this place is now constituted by the quantity of air now occupying it. Notice that the extension of the wine and that of the air are two different sets of bodies, and so the place inside the wine bottle was constituted by two different pieces of extension. But, since these two pieces of extension have the same size, shape and relation to the body surrounding it, that is, the bottle, it is called one and the same “place” even though, strictly speaking, it is made up of two different pieces of extension. Therefore, so long as bodies of the same shape, size and position continue to replace each other, it is considered one and the same place.

This assimilation of a place or space with the body constituting it gives rise to an interesting philosophical problem. Since a place is identical with the body constituting it, how does a place retain its identity and, therefore, remain the “same” place when it is replaced by another body that now constitutes it? A return to the wine bottle example will help to illustrate this point. Recall that first the extension of the wine constituted the place inside the bottle and then, after the wine was finished, that place inside the body was constituted by the extension of the air now occupying it. So, since the wine’s extension is different from the air’s extension, it seems to follow that the place inside the wine bottle is not the exactly same place but two different places at two different times. It is difficult to see how Descartes would address this issue.

Another important consequence of Descartes’ assimilation of bodies and space is that a vacuum or an empty space is unintelligible. This is because an empty space, according to Descartes, would just be a non-extended space, which is impossible. A return to the wine bottle will further illustrate this point. Notice that the place inside the wine bottle was first constituted by the wine and then by air. These are two different kinds of extended things, but they are extended things nonetheless. Accordingly, the place inside the bottle is constituted first by one body (the wine) and then by another (air). But suppose that all extension is removed from the bottle so that there is an “empty space.” Now, distance is a mode requiring extension to exist, for it makes no sense to speak of spatial distance without space or extension. So, under these circumstances, no mode of distance could exist inside the bottle. That is, no distance would exist between the bottle’s sides, and therefore the sides would touch. Therefore, an empty space cannot exist between two or more bodies.

Descartes’ close assimilation of body and space, his rejection of the vacuum, and some textual issues have lead many to infer an asymmetry in his metaphysics of thinking and extended things. This asymmetry is found in the claim that particular minds are substances for Descartes but not particular bodies. Rather, these considerations indicate to some that only the whole, physical universe is a substance, while particular bodies, for example, the wine bottle, are modes of that substance. Though the textual issues are many, the main philosophical problem stems from the rejection of the vacuum. The argument goes like this: particular bodies are not really distinct substances, because two or more particular bodies cannot be clearly and distinctly understood with an empty space between them; that is, they are not separable from each other, even by the power of God. Hence, particular bodies are not substances, and therefore they must be modes. However, this line of reasoning is a result of misunderstanding the criterion for a real distinction. Instead of trying to understand two bodies with an empty space between them, one body should be understood all by itself so that God could have created a world with that body, for example, the wine bottle, as its only existent. Hence, since it requires only God’s concurrence to exist, it is a substance that is really distinct from all other thinking and extended substances. Although difficulties also arise for this argument from Descartes’ account of bodily surfaces as a mode shared between bodies, these are too complex to address here. But, suffice it to say that the textual evidence is also in favor of the claim that Descartes, despite the unforeseen problem about surfaces, maintained that particular bodies are substances. The most telling piece of textual evidence is found in a 1642 letter to Gibeuf:

From the simple fact that I consider two halves of a part of matter, however small it may be, as two complete substances . . . I conclude with certainty that they are really divisible. (AT III 477: CSMK 202-203

These considerations in general, and this quotation in particular, lead to another distinct feature of Cartesian body, namely that extension is infinitely divisible. The point is that no matter how small a piece of matter, it can always be divided in half, and then each half can itself be divided in half, and so on to infinity. These considerations about the vacuum and the infinite divisibility of extension amount to a rejection of atomism. Atomism is a school of thought going back to the ancients, which received a revival in the 17th century most notably in the philosophy and science of Pierre Gassendi. On this account, all change in the universe could be explained by the movements of very small, indivisible particles called “atoms” in a void or empty space. But, if Descartes’ arguments for rejecting the vacuum and the infinite divisibility of matter are sound, then atomism must be false, since the existence of indivisible atoms and an empty space would both be unintelligible.

c. Physics

Descartes devised a non-atomistic, mechanistic physics in which all physical phenomena were to be explain by the configuration and motion of a body’s miniscule parts. This mechanistic physics is also a point of fundamental difference between the Cartesian and Scholastic-Aristotelian schools of thought. For the latter (as Descartes understood them), the regular behavior of inanimate bodies was explained by certain ends towards which those bodies strive. Descartes, on the other hand, thought human effort is better directed toward the discovery of the mechanistic causes of things given the uselessness of final causal explanations and how it is vain to seek God’s purposes. Furthermore, Descartes maintained that the geometric method should also be applied to physics so that results are deduced from the clear and distinct perceptions of the geometrical or quantifiable properties found in bodies, that is, size, shape, motion, determination (or direction), quantity, and so forth.

Perhaps the most concise summary of Descartes’ general view of the physical universe is found in part III, section 46 of the Principles:

From what has already been said we have established that all the bodies in the universe are composed of one and the same matter, which is divisible into indefinitely many parts, and is in fact divided into a large number of parts which move in different directions and have a sort of circular motion; moreover, the same quantity of motion is always preserved in the universe. (AT VIIIA 100: CSM I 256)

Since the matter constituting the physical universe and its divisibility were previously discussed, a brief explanation of the circular motion of bodies and the preservation of motion is in order. The first thesis is derived from God’s immutability and implies that no quantity of motion is ever added to or subtracted from the universe, but rather quantities of motion are merely passed from one body to another. God’s immutability is also used to support the first law of motion, which is that “each and everything, in so far as it can, always continues in the same state; and thus what is once in motion always continues in motion” (AT VIIIA 62-63: CSM I 241). This principle indicates that something will remain in a given state as long as it is not being affected by some external cause. So a body moving at a certain speed will continue to move at that speed indefinitely unless something comes along to change it. The second thesis about the circular motion of bodies is discussed at Principles, part II, section 33. This claim is based on the earlier thesis that the physical universe is a plenum of contiguous bodies. On this account, one moving body must collide with and replace another body, which, in turn, is set in motion and collides with another body, replacing it and so on. But, at the end of this series of collisions and replacements, the last body moved must then collide with and replace the first body in the sequence. To illustrate: suppose that body A collides with and replaces body B, B replaces C, C replaces D, and then D replaces A. This is known as a Cartesian vortex.

Descartes’ second law of motion is that “all motion is in itself rectilinear; and hence any body moving in a circle always tends to move away from the center of the circle which it describes” (AT VIIIA 63-64: CSM I 241-242). This is justified by God’s immutability and simplicity in that he will preserve a quantity of motion in the exact form in which it is occurring until some created things comes along to change it. The principle expressed here is that any body considered all by itself tends to move in a straight line unless it collides with another body, which deflects it. Notice that this is a thesis about any body left all by itself, and so only lone bodies will continue to move in a straight line. However, since the physical world is a plenum, bodies are not all by themselves but constantly colliding with one another, which gives rise to Cartesian vortices as explained above.

The third general law of motion, in turn, governs the collision and deflection of bodies in motion. This third law is that “if a body collides with another body that is stronger than itself, it loses none of its motion; but if it collides with a weaker body, it loses a quantity of motion” (AT VIIIA 65: CSM I 242). This law expresses the principle that if a body’s movement in a straight line is less resistant than a stronger body with which it collides, then it won’t lose any of its motion but its direction will be changed. But if the body collides with a weaker body, then the first body loses a quantity of motion equal to that given in the second. Notice that all three of these principles doe not employ the goals or purposes (that is, final causes) utilized in Scholastic-Aristotelian physics as Descartes understood it but only the most general laws of the mechanisms of bodies by means of their contact and motion.

d. Animal and Human Bodies

In part five of the Discourse on Method, Descartes examines the nature of animals and how they are to be distinguished from human beings. Here Descartes argues that if a machine were made with the outward appearance of some animal lacking reason, like a monkey, it would be indistinguishable from a real specimen of that animal found in nature. But if such a machine of a human being were made, it would be readily distinguishable from a real human being due to its inability to use language. Descartes’ point is that the use of language is a sign of rationality and only things endowed with minds or souls are rational. Hence, it follows that no animal has an immaterial mind or soul. For Descartes this also means that animals do not, strictly speaking, have sensations like hunger, thirst and pain. Rather, squeals of pain, for instance, are mere mechanical reactions to external stimuli without any sensation of pain. In other words, hitting a dog with a stick, for example, is a kind of input and the squeal that follows would be merely output, but the dog did not feel anything at all and could not feel pain unless it was endowed with a mind. Humans, however, are endowed with minds or rational souls, and therefore they can use language and feel sensations like hunger, thirst, and pain. Indeed, this Cartesian “fact” is at the heart of Descartes’ argument for the union of the mind with the body summarized near the end of part five of the Discourseand laid out in full in the Sixth Meditation.

Yet Descartes still admits that both animal and human bodies can be best understood to be “machine[s] made of earth, which God forms.” (AT XI 120: CSM I 99). The point is that just as the workings of a clock can be best understood by means of the configuration and motion of its parts so also with animal and human bodies. Indeed, the heart of an animal and that of a human being are so much alike that he advises the reader unversed in anatomy “to have the heart of some large animal with lungs dissected before him (for such a heart is in all respects sufficiently like that of a man), and be shown the two chambers or cavities which are present in it” (AT VI 47: CSM I 134). He then goes on to describe in some detail the motion of the blood through the heart in order to explain that when the heart hardens it is not contracting but really swelling in such a way as to allow more blood into a given cavity. Although this account goes contrary to the (more correct) observation made by William Harvey, an Englishman who published a book on the circulation of the blood in 1628, Descartes argues that his explanation has the force of geometrical demonstration. Accordingly, the physiology and biology of human bodies, considered without regard for those functions requiring the soul to operate, should be conducted in the same way as the physiology and biology of animal bodies, namely via the application of the geometrical method to the configuration and motion of parts.

9. Sensations and Passions

In his last published work, Passions of the Soul, Descartes provides accounts of how various motions in the body cause sensations and passions to arise in the soul. He begins by making several observations about the mind-body relation. The whole mind is in the whole body and the whole in each of its parts but yet its primary seat is in a little gland at the center of the brain now known as the “pineal gland.” Descartes is not explicit about what he means by “the whole mind in the whole body and the whole in each of its parts.” But this was not an uncommon way of characterizing how the soul is united to the body at Descartes’ time. The main point was that the soul makes a human body truly human; that is, makes it a living human body and not merely a corpse. Given Descartes’ unexplained use of this phrase, it is reasonable to suppose that he used it in the way his contemporaries would have understood it. So the mind is united to the whole body and the whole in each of its parts insofar as it is a soul or principle of life. Accordingly, the body’s union with the soul makes it a living human body or a human body, strictly speaking (see letter to Mersenne dated 9 February 1645). But, the “primary seat”, that is, the place where the soul performs its primary functions, is the point where the mind is, in some sense, affected by the body, namely the pineal gland.

Descartes maintains further that all sensations depend on the nerves, which extend from the brain to the body’s extremities in the form of tiny fibers encased by tube-like membranes. These fibers float in a very fine matter known as the “animal spirits.” This allows these fibers to float freely so that anything causing the slightest motion anywhere in the body will cause movement in that part of the brain where the fiber is attached. The variety of different movements of the animals spirits cause a variety of different sensations not in the part of the body originally affected but only in the brain and ultimately in the pineal gland. So, strictly speaking, pain does not occur in the foot when a toe is stubbed but only in the brain. This, in turn, may cause the widening or narrowing of pores in the brain so as to direct the animals spirits to various muscles and make them move. For example, the sensation of heat is produced by the imperceptible particles in the pot of boiling water, which caused the movement of the animal spirits in the nerves terminating at the end of the hand. These animal spirits then move the fibers extending to the brain through the tube of nerves causing the sensation of pain. This then causes various pores to widen or narrow in the brain so as to direct the animals spirits to the muscles of the arm and cause it to quickly move the hand away from the heat in order to remove it from harm. This is the model for how all sensations occur.

These sensations may also cause certain emotions or passions in the mind. However, different sensations do not give rise to different passions because of the difference in objects but only in regards to the various ways these things are beneficial, harmful or important for us. Accordingly, the function of the passions is to dispose the soul to want things that are useful and to persist in this desire Moreover, the same animal spirits causing these passions also dispose the body to move in order to attain them. For example, the sight of an ice cream parlor, caused by the movement of the animal spirits in the eye and through the nerves to the brain and pineal gland, might also cause the passion of desire to arise. These same animal spirits would then dispose the body to move (for example, toward the ice cream parlor) in order to attain the goal of eating ice cream thereby satisfying this desire. Descartes goes on to argue that there are only six primitive passions, namely wonder, love, hatred, desire, joy and sadness. All other passions are either composed of some combination of these primitives or are species of one of these six genera. Much of the rest of parts 2 and 3 of the Passions of the Soul is devoted to detailed explications of these six primitive passions and their respective species.

10. Morality

a. The Provisional Moral Code

In Part 3 of the Discourse on Method, Descartes lays out a provisional moral code by which he plans to live while engaged in his methodological doubt in search of absolute certainty. This code of “three or four” rules or maxims is established so that he is not frozen by uncertainty in the practical affairs of life. These maxims can be paraphrased as follows:

1. To obey the laws and customs of my country, holding constantly to the Catholic religion, and governing myself in all other matters according to the most moderate opinions accepted in practice by the most sensible people.
2. To be as firm and decisive in action as possible and to follow even the most doubtful opinions once they have been adopted.
3. Try to master myself rather than fortune, and change my desires rather than the order of the world.
4. Review the various professions and chose the best (AT VI 23-28: CSM I 122-125).

The main thrust of the first maxim is to live a moderate and sensible life while his previously held beliefs have been discarded due to their uncertainty. Accordingly, it makes sense to defer judgment about such matters until certainty is found. Presumably Descartes defers to the laws and customs of the country in which he lives because of the improbability of them leading him onto the wrong path while his own moral beliefs have been suspended. Also, the actions of sensible people, who avoid the extremes and take the middle road, can provide a temporary guide to action until his moral beliefs have been established with absolute certainty. Moreover, although Descartes does seems to bring his religious beliefs into doubt in the Meditations, he does not do so in the Discourse. Since religious beliefs can be accepted on faith without absolutely certain rational justification, they are not subject to methodological doubt as employed in the Discourse. Accordingly, his religious beliefs can also serve as guides for moral conduct during this period of doubt. Therefore, the first maxim is intended to provide Descartes with guides or touchstones that will most likely lead to the performance of morally good actions.

The second maxim expresses a firmness of action so as to avoid the inaction produced by hesitation and uncertainty. Descartes uses the example of a traveler lost in a forest. This traveler should not wander about or even stand still for then he will never find his way. Instead, he should keep walking in a straight line and should never change his direction for slight reasons. Hence, although the traveler may not end up where he wants, at least he will be better off than in the middle of a forest. Similarly, since practical action must usually be performed without delay, there usually is not time to discover the truest or most certain course of action, but one must follow the most probable route. Moreover, even if no route seems most probable, some route must be chosen and resolutely acted upon and treated as the most true and certain. By following this maxim, Descartes hopes to avoid the regrets experienced by those who set out on a supposedly good course that they later judge to be bad.

The third maxim enjoins Descartes to master himself and not fortune. This is based on the realization that all that is in his control are his own thoughts and nothing else. Hence, most things are out of his control. This has several implications. First, if he has done his best but fails to achieve something, then it follows that it was not within his power to achieve it. This is because his own best efforts were not sufficient to achieve that end, and so whatever effort would be sufficient is beyond his abilities. The second implication is that he should desire only those things that are within his power to obtain, and so he should control his desires rather than try to master things beyond his control. In this way, Descartes hopes to avoid the regret experienced by those who have desires that cannot be satisfied, because this satisfaction lies beyond their grasp so that one should not desire health when ill nor freedom when imprisoned.

It is difficult to see why the fourth maxim is included. Indeed, Descartes himself seems hesitant about including it when he states at the outset that his provisional moral code consists of “three or four maxims.” Although he does not examine other occupations, Descartes is content with his current work because of the pleasure he receives from discovering new and not widely known truths. This seems to imply the correct choice of occupation can ensure a degree of contentedness that could not be otherwise achieved if one is engaged in an occupation for which one is not suited. Descartes also claims that his current occupation is the basis of the other three maxims, because it is his current plan to continue his instruction that gave rise to them. He concludes with a brief discussion of how his occupational path leads to the acquisition of knowledge, which, in turn, will lead to all the true goods within his grasp. His final point is that learning how best to judge what is good and bad makes it possible to act well and achieve all attainable virtues and goods. Happiness is assured when this point is reached with certainty.

b. Generosity

After the Discourse of 1637, Descartes did not take up the issue of morality in any significant way again until his correspondence with Princess Elizabeth in 1643, which culminated in his remarks about generosity in part 3 of the Passions of the Soul. Given the temporal distance between his main reflections on morality, it is easy to attribute to Descartes two moral systems – the provisional moral code and the ethics of generosity. But Descartes’ later moral thinking retains versions of the second and third maxim without much mention of the first and fourth. This indicates that Descartes’ later moral theory is really an extension of his earlier thought with the second and third maxims at its core. At Passions, part 3, section 153, Descartes claims that the virtue of generosity “causes a person’s self-esteem to be as great as it may legitimately be” and has two components. First is knowing that only the freedom to dispose volitions is in anyone’s power. Accordingly, people should only be praised or blamed for using one’s freedom either well or poorly. The second component is the feeling of a “firm and constant resolution” to use one’s freedom well such that one can never lack the will to carry out whatever has been judged to be best.

Notice that both components of generosity relate to the second and third maxim of the earlier provisional moral code. The first component is reminiscent of the third maxim in its acknowledgment of people’s freedom of choice and the control they have over the disposition of their will or desire, and therefore they should be praised and blamed only for those things that are within their grasp. The second component relates to the second maxim in that both pertain to firm and resolute action. Generosity requires a resolute conviction to use free will correctly, while the second maxim is a resolution to stick to the judgment most likely to lead to a good action absent a significant reason for changing course. However, a difference between these two moral codes is that the provisional moral code of the Discourse focuses on the correct use and resolute enactment of probable judgments, while the later ethics of generosity emphasizes a firm resolution to use free will correctly. Hence, in both moral systems, the correct use of mental faculties, namely judgment and free will, and the resolute pursuit of what is judged to be good is to be enacted. This, in turn, should lead us to a true state of generosity so as to legitimately esteem ourselves as having correctly used those faculties through which humans are most in the likeness of God.

11. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

• Descartes, René, Oeuvres de Descartes, eds. Charles Adam and Paul Tannery, Paris: Vrin, originally published 1987-1913.
  • This is still the standard edition of all of Descartes’ works and correspondence in their original languages. Cited in the text as AT volume, page.
• Descartes, René, The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, trans. John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch and Anthony Kenny, Cambridge: Cambridge Universiety Press, 3 vols.1984-1991.
  • This is the standard English translation of Descartes philosophical works and correspondence. Cited in the text as CSM or CSMK volume, page.

b. Secondary Sources

• Ariew, Roger, Marjorie GRené, eds., Descartes and His Contemporaries: Meditations, Objections, and Replies, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1995.
  • This is a collection of essays by prominent scholars about various issues raised in the Meditations, objections to them and the adequacy or inadequacy of Descartes’ replies.
• Broughton, Janet, Descartes’s Method of Doubt, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2003.
  • A study of Descartes’ method and its results.
• Dicker, Georges, Descartes: An Analytical and Historical Introduction, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1993.
  • A clear and concise introduction to Descartes’ philosophy.
• Frankfurt, Harry, Demons, Dreamers and Madmen: the Defense of Reason in Descartes’ Meditations, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1970.
  • A classic examination of Descartes’ Meditations.
• Garber, Daniel, Descartes’ Metaphysical Physics, Chicago and London: University of Chicago Press, 1992.
  • Provides a detailed account of Cartesian science and its metaphysical foundations.
• Gaukroger, Stephen, Descartes: An Intellectual Biography, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995.
  • Though somewhat technical, this is a very good biography of Descartes’ intellectual development emphasizing his early years and his interests in mathematics and science.
• Kenny, Anthony, Descartes: A Study of His Philosophy, New York: Random House, 1968.
  • A classic study of Descartes’ philosophy through the Meditations.
• Marshall, John, Descartes’s Moral Theory, Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press, 1998.
  • One of the few book length explications of Descartes’ moral theory.
• Rodis-Lewis, Genevieve, Descartes: His Life and Thought, trans. Jane Marie Todd, Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press, 1998
  • This is a very readable and enjoyable biography.
• Rozemond, Marleen, Descartes’s Dualism, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1998.
  • Provides an interpretation of the real distinction between mind and body, their causal interaction and theory of sensation within the context of late Scholastic theories of soul-body union and sensation.
• Secada, Jorge, Cartesian Metaphysics: The Late Scholastic Origins of Modern Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
  • An at times technical, though readable, account of the whole of Descartes’ metaphysics from within the context of late Scholasticism.
• Skirry, Justin, Descartes and the Metaphysics of Human Nature, London: Thoemmes-Continuum Press, 2005.
  • Provides an account of Descartes’ theory of mind-body union and how it helps him to avoid the mind-body problem.
• Verbeek, Theo, Descartes and the Dutch: Early Reactions to Cartesian Philosophy 1637-1650,Carbondale: Southern Illinois University Press, 1994.
  • Provides a history and account of the controversies at Utrecht and Leiden.
• Williston, Byron and Andre Gomby, eds., Passion and Virtue in Descartes, New York: Humanity Books, 2003.
  • An anthology of essays by many noted scholars on Descartes’ theory of the passions and aspects of his later moral theory.
• Williams, Bernard, Descartes: The Project of Pure Enquiry, Sussex: Harvester Press, 1978.
  • Classic account of Descartes’ philosophy in general.
• Wilson, Margaret, Descartes, London and Boston: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1978.
  • A classic in Descartes scholarship covering the whole of his philosophy as expressed in the Meditations.

Author Information

Justin Skirry
Email: jskirry@yahoo.com
Nebraska-Wesleyan University
U. S. A.

Sablé, Madeleine de Souvré, Marquise De (1598—1678)

A prominent salonnière in seventeenth-century Paris, Madame de Sablé has long occupied the background of early modern French philosophy. She has survived in intellectual history as the patron of La Rochefoucauld, as the hostess of a theological salon, and as the correspondent of Blaise Pascal and Antoine Arnauld. These ancillary roles have obscured her original contributions to moral philosophy in her writings. In her maxims, Sablé develops a distinctive critique of moral virtue. She claims that virtue is a mask of vice; usually of pride, and that self-interest is the habitual motor behind altruistic actions. This critique of virtue is a social critique inasmuch as it unmasks the mechanism of self-aggrandizement under the cover of virtue in the court hierarchy of the period. With her characteristic moderation, Sablé insists that friendship constitutes an exception to the social charade of masked self-interest. In the intimacies of mutually sacrificial friendship, authentic virtue can flourish. Sablé’s dismissal of the claims of natural moral virtue, and her fideistic insistence that true moral order can only be grasped in the light of faith, reflect her adherence to Jansenism, the neo-Augustinian movement in Catholicism which she defended in both civil and ecclesiastical circles.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. Works
3. Philosophical Theses
   1. Virtue Theory
   2. Ethics of Love
   3. Moral Rigorism
   4. Epistemology and Skepticism
4. Interpretation and Relevance
5. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Madeleine de Souvré was born in 1598 to an ancient aristocratic family in Le Perche, a region in western France. Prominent in court circles, her father Gilles de Souvré was a marshal of France and served as the governor of Louis XIII in his minority. Her mother was Françoise de Bailleul, dame de Renouard. In the political controversies of the period, the Souvré family sided with the parti dévot, a faction of militant Catholics who wanted France’s foreign policy to stress an international Catholic alliance (notably with Spain and Austria) against the Protestant, Orthodox, and Islamic powers. In 1610 Madeleine de Souvré was named lady-in-waiting to Queen Marie de Medicis, the mother of Louis XIII and the regent of France. Although little is known about Mademoiselle de Souvré’s education, it is clear that early in her education she acquired a knowledge of Spanish literature. Balthasar Gracián’s L’oraculo manual would prove especially influential in Sablé’s later reflections on the nature of virtue.

In 1614, Madeleine de Souvré married Philippe Emmanuel de Laval, marquis de Sablé. Although Madame de Sablé would bear nine children, only four survived childhood: Urbain, marquis de Bois-Dauphin; Henri, Bishop of La Rochelle; Guy, a military officer; and Marie, a cloistered nun. By all accounts, the marriage was an unhappy one, for both spouses conducted scarcely concealed romantic affairs as they led increasingly separate existences.

From the beginning of her marriage, Sablé frequented the literary salons of Paris. Three in particular developed her philosophical culture. In the celebrated chambre bleu of Madame de Rambouillet, Sablé became an ardent reader of the works of Montaigne and was introduced to the theories of Descartes. At the literary samedis of Mademoiselle de Scudéry, Sablé studied the gradations of love that were the central preoccupation of the salon’s literary production. At the salon of Mademoiselle de Montpensier, Sablé practiced the literary vogue of the portrait moral, in which the author sketched the characteristic vices and virtues of a prominent courtier presented under a pseudonym. This predilection for moral psychology and skepticism concerning the claims of knowledge helped shape the philosophical themes Sablé would treat in her writings of maturity.

The 1640s inaugurated a more somber period in Sablé’s life. In 1640, the death of her husband left her in a precarious financial situation, and a family quarrel over the inheritance provoked a lawsuit against her eldest son, Urbain. In 1646, the death of her son Guy at the battle of Dunkirk plunged her into prolonged mourning.

The period also marked a religious conversion. Sablé increasingly frequented the Parisian convent of Port-Royal, the citadel of the Jansenist movement. Jansenism stressed the depth of human depravity, complete reliance on grace for salvation, and the need to lead an austere moral life opposed to the amusements of the world. Sablé’s moral qualms about frequent reception of the sacraments occasioned Antoine Arnauld’s composition of On Frequent Communion (1642), a treatise attacking the alleged moral laxism of the Jesuits. By the 1650s Sablé would emerge as a partisan of Jansenism and as a prominent defender of the embattled convent of Port-Royal, but her continued participation in the salon culture of the capital would raise doubts as to the depth of her conversion to the cause’s moral rigorism.

By the end of the decade, Sablé emerged as the hostess of her own salon, first in the fashionable Place Royale (1648-1655) and then in the apartment she had constructed on the grounds of the Port-Royal convent (1655-1678). The salon specialized in the production of the literary genre of the maxime, a concise, epigrammatic phrase that explored the contradictions of human psychology. A salon member, François, duc de La Rochefoucauld, quickly emerged as the master of the genre. Sablé served as a critic and editor for La Rochefoucauld’s maxims, but she also composed her own maxims, which were published posthumously. Philosophical sessions included papers by Madame de Brégy on the Stoicism of Epictetus, Clausure on Cartesianism, Sourdis on the problem of the vacuum, and Arnauld d’Andilly on the limits of patriotism. As in other salons, the nature and varieties of love were the primary topic of debate. Leading philosophical members of the salon included Blaise Pascal, Gilberte Pascal Périer, Antoine Arnauld, Pierre Nicole, and Madame de Sévigné.

As she reemerged into Parisian high society, Sablé revealed her diplomatic skills. During the Fronde (1648-1653), the intermittent civil war that pitted aristocrats and parliamentarians against the throne, she managed to maintain close friendships with members of both sides. Despite her allegiance to Jansenism, she included Jesuits and anti-Jansenist laity among her salon guests. When the persecution of the Jansenists, especially the nuns of Port-Royal, intensified in the 1660s, she labored to affect the reconciliation of the warring factions. Pope Clement IX’s “Peace of the Church” (1669), which lifted the censures from the Port-Royal community, reflected in part her interventions at the papal court.

Madame de Sablé died in her Port-Royal apartment on January 16, 1678.

2. Works

Sablé’s extant writings fall into three categories: a collection of maxims, a treatise on friendship, and her letters.

Published posthumously in 1678 by Abbé Nicolas d’Ailly, Maximes de Mme la Marquise de Sablé constitutes Sablé’s most substantial contribution to moral philosophy. In this collection of maxims, Sablé analyzes the vices that mask themselves as virtues in the aristocratic society of the period. Unlike her colleague La Rochefoucauld, however, she insists that love constitutes an exception to the domination of vice. Although her maxims focus primarily on questions of virtue and vice, Sablé also studies epistemological questions, especially those surrounding the relationship between power and knowledge. In her skeptical study of virtue and power, Sablé is clearly influenced by Montaigne, Graci‡n, and La Rochefoucauld. She differs from her sources, however, in the characteristic moderation by which she judges the influence of self-interest in social relations.

The subsequent history of Sablé’s maximes constitutes a cautionary tale on the survival of works by women philosophers. Often published in anthologies featuring La Rochefoucauld’s maxims, Sablé’s maxims were often falsely attributed to her protégé. Sablé’s most extensive maxim, actually a miniature essay condemning attendance at theatrical performances (maxim no. 80), was attributed for centuries to Blaise Pascal. A passage in Pascal’s Pensées condemning the theater bears a striking resemblance to the phrases of Sablé. Critics concluded that it must have been Sablé who copied Pascal, given the literary preeminence of the latter. The influential Brunschvicg (1904) and Lafuma (1951) editions of Pascal in the early twentieth century continued this misattribution. Only at the end of the twentieth century was this critique of theater reattributed to Sablé herself. Sellier’s recent edition of the Pensées (1991, 2000) notes that it was clearly Pascal who copied and altered the critique of theater originally authored by Sablé.

First published by Victor Cousin in the nineteenth-century, Sablé’s brief treatise On Friendship argues that virtue can be experienced within the confines of intimate friendship. Unlike other social relationships, where motivations remain masked and vulnerable to misinterpretation, friendship permits one to discover the internal motivation behind the external action of one’s partner.

An extensive correspondence of Sablé also survives in the archives of the Bibliothèque nationale de France and in scattered biographical publications. Barthélemy’s scholarly study of Sablé’s salon associates (1865) provides an ample selection of the letters written by and to the marquise. Although most of the letters deal with practical affairs concerning Sablé’s person, family, and salon, some of the letters deal with philosophical issues related to the religious controversies of the period. Such issues include the relationship between grace and free will, the limits of civil and ecclesiastical authority in matters of conscience, and the immortality of the human soul. Philosophical correspondents include Blaise Pascal, Antoine Arnauld, Mère Angélique Arnauld, Mère Agnès Arnauld, Mère Angélique de Saint-Jean Arnauld d’Andilly, Pierre Nicole, Antoine Menjot, and Jean Domat.

3. Philosophical Theses

Sablé’s philosophical reflections are limited to the areas of ethics and epistemology. In moral philosophy, she focuses on the tendency of the vice of pride to disguise itself as virtue. In epistemology, she examines the relationship between power and the claims to truth. In both her moral theory and her theory of knowledge, she mitigates her skepticism. Despite the presence of vice behind many surface virtues, some apparently virtuous actions actually reflect authentic virtue in the agent. Although power has corrupted some claims to truth in court society, certain claims to truth – notably claims to religious truth based on obedience to divine revelation – are more than credible.

a. Virtue Theory

In many passages, Sablé condemns apparent exercises of virtue as expressions of vice. Altruism often masks the will to dominate the other. Self-aggrandizement is the motor of apparently charitable action. Her critique of virtue is a political critique, inasmuch as she examines the depredations of occulted egoism in the culture of the court.

Sablé analyzes how this masked vice operates within the polite society of the period. “Virtue is not always where one sees actions that appear virtuous. Sometimes one only recognizes a favor in order to establish one’s reputation or even to be more firmly ungrateful toward favors one does not wish to recognize” (Maxim no. 74). Rather than expressing spontaneous gratitude, public expressions of thanksgiving are a calculated expression of one’s desire to acquire social power or to elude the moral duty to recognize one’s actual debts. The pivot of salon culture, polite conversation, similarly turns on the self’s desire to remain the center of attention rather than on any concern to accommodate the needs of others. “Everyone is so busy with her interests and passions that she always wants to talk about them without entering into the interests and passions of those with whom she is speaking, although they have the same need to be heard and helped” (Maxim no. 29). Under the guise of charitable speech and action, high society’s conventions of politeness permit the individual to remain enclosed within selfish interests that refuse to recognize, let alone yield to, the more pressing claims of the neighbor.

Sablé’s moral critique of society is especially pronounced in her treatment of wealth. Genteel society’s surface claim to prize the acquisition of virtue is undercut by its emotional concentration on the vagaries of material fortune. It is social status, not moral status, that actually dominates human concern. “Good fortune almost always makes some change in the procedure, the tone, and the manner of conversation and action…if we esteemed virtue more than any other thing, then neither any favor nor any promotion would ever change the heart or the face of people” (Maxim no.32). Our emotional reaction to the slightest promotion or demotion in social status, contrasted with our emotional indifference to the commission of a vice, indicates that it is social power rather than perfection in virtue that constitutes our supreme good in the hierarchy of values. In particular, the acquisition of money focuses our desires. “It is quite a common fault never to be happy with one’s fortune and never unhappy with one’s soul” (Maxim no.67). Despite the insistence on the paramount value of religious and moral values in the political and educational rhetoric of the period, it is economic status that actually occupies pride of place. The hope of enhancement of that status and the fear of its erosion stubbornly poisons public virtuous action.

b. Ethics of Love

Despite the omnipresence of vice posing as virtue in the public arena, authentic virtue survives in the arena of interpersonal friendship. Sablé argues that in the experience of love, one acquires knowledge of the other’s moral motivation that cannot be doubted. It is here that altruism and self-sacrifice actually operate.

Unlike political exercises of altruism, love by its nature possesses an internal transparency that does not permit it to be mistaken for another disposition. “Love has a character so particular that one can neither hide it where it is nor pretend it exists where it is not” (Maxim no.80). Other virtues may be feigned if the agent has ulterior motives for dominating the other. In love, however, the external acts and the internal dispositions of the agent become one. “Love is to the soul of the one who loves what the soul is to the body of the one it animates” (Maxim no. 79).

Sablé insists that it is friendship rather than romance that constitutes the proper locus for the emergence of this virtuous love. Freed from passion, the mature experience of friendship permits one to appreciate the other moral virtues of one’s partner disclosed in the transparency of mutual love. “Friendship is a species of virtue which can only be founded upon the esteem of the person loved, that is, upon qualities of the soul, such as fidelity, generosity and discretion, and on good qualities of mind” (Of Friendship). This disclosure of the other person’s moral constitution through the experience of friendship requires a basic equality between the partners. “It is also necessary that friendship be reciprocal, because in friendship one cannot, as in romantic love, love without being loved” (On Friendship). Whereas romantic love can veil the moral motivations of the moral agent due to passion and the inequality of the partners, the sober, egalitarian relation of friendship permits a veridical disclosure of moral character through mutual respect and sacrifice.

Sablé’s praise of the virtue present in friendship contrasts sharply with the critique of love developed by her colleague La Rochefoucauld. In his own maxims, La Rochefoucald condemns friendship as only another outcropping of vicious self-centeredness. “What humanity has named friendship is only a business, a reciprocal arrangement of interests, only an exchange of services. At bottom, it is only a type of commerce where self-love is always designing to win something” (Maxim. No 83). For La Rochefoucauld, the egotism disguised as virtue permeates both the public and private spheres of human interaction. For Sablé, however, the empire of vice is more limited. In the intimate sphere of interpersonal love, authentic virtue can manifest itself and be properly interpreted by the beloved other. It is only in egalitarian friendship, however, that virtue can make such a rare and transparent manifestation, and not in the passion of romance nor in the hierarchy of marriage.

c. Moral Rigorism

In critiquing the predominant vices of her society, Sablé devotes particular attention to the theater. Her most famous maxim is an extended paragraph-long meditation on the dangers of attendance at theatrical performances. Her condemnation of the theater is categorical. “All the great diversions are dangerous for the Christian life, but among all those which the world has invented, there is none greater to fear than the theater” (Maxim no. 80). This censure of the theater is typical of the moral rigorism of the Jansenist movement. Pierre Nicole, a close friend and correspondent of Sablé, presented the most sustained Jansenist brief against theatrical performances in his Traité de la Comédie (1667).

Sablé’s argument against attendance at theatrical performances differs sensibly from the standard arguments used by Christian moralists of the period. The moral argument against Christian involvement in the theater usually appeared for two reasons. First, many of the pieces played upon the stage of the period were licentious in nature. As such, they could only constitute occasions of sin, which the upright Christian should scrupulously avoid. Second, the theaters themselves were venues for moral licentiousness. Several Parisian theaters were notorious for the prostitution openly practiced in their corridors. Such moral considerations had led both the Catholic and Protestant churches to ban actors from the sacraments and to deny church burial to them.

For Sablé, however, it is not the licentiousness of the theater that constitutes its greatest moral danger. The actual moral danger lies in the attractiveness with which the theater can present counterfeits of reasonable love among the characters on the stage. Imitating the romantic plays they watch, audience members can easily develop sentiments of affection that have been ripped out of their proper place in the sober cultivation of friendship in actual life. “”It [the theater] is so natural and so delicate a representation of the passions that it makes them come alive and makes them arise in our hearts. This is especially true of love when one presents a chaste and honest love, because the more it seems innocent to innocent souls, the more are those souls susceptible to theater’s effects” (Maxim no. 81). The temptation of obvious vice in licentious plays can be easily combated, but the seduction of a more innocent, sentimental love in decent plays is more difficult to resist. By a mimetic effect, such romantic idylls encourage the audience to cultivate loving relationships rooted in sentiment for phantom partners rather than in virtuous sacrifice for actual partners. The one social venue where authentic virtue has the greatest place to emerge, egalitarian friendship, has been distorted by the theater into a realm of fantasy untethered from moral endeavor. The primness of the sentiments celebrated by decent theatrical pieces does not diminish the moral dangers fostered by such an illusion of love.

d. Epistemology and Skepticism

Echoing Montaigne, whom she had studied during her early career as a salonnière, Sablé often confesses skepticism concerning the claims of human knowledge. Authentic science ultimately affirms the incertitude of its own propositions and the depth of human ignorance. To this Renaissance vein of skepticism, Sablé adds her own distinctive emphases. Human error is not due to the generic infirmity of the human mind alone; it is often induced by the manipulations of power practiced in cultivated society. Faithful to her Jansenist creed, Sablé insists that religious and moral knowledge grounded upon divine self-revelation is exempt from the dangers of self-deception.

In several passages, Sablé develops her own version of Socratic ignorance. The truly wise person acknowledges his or her lack of knowledge. “The greatest wisdom of humanity is to know its folly” (Maxim no. 8). Authentic pursuit of knowledge permits the seeker to affirm the utter lack of certain knowledge that is the lot of the human mind. “The study of and search for truth only make us see, by experience, the ignorance that is naturally ours” (Maxim no. 38).

If error is endemic to human noetic experience, due to the finitude and the fallibility of the human intellect, then contemporary society has increased the risk of error by the emphasis it places upon external rhetorical devices. The polite conversation of the salon is exemplary of the ease with which an inquiring subject can be seduced into error by the power of a seductive rhetoric that masks insubstantial or fallacious truth-claims. “The exterior and the circumstances often elicit greater respect than the interior and the reality. A poor manner spoils everything, even justice and reason. The how is the most important of things. The appearance we give gilds, trims, and sweetens even the most troubling things” (Maxim no. 48). In a society that prizes external ornament, persuasive rhetoric can easily make the false credible; conversely, threadbare rhetoric can easily make the truth appear implausible. The development of knowledge is not a serene adjudication of the conflicting evidence concerning a controverted issue; it is embedded in a network of power where the most attractive, rather than the most truthful, proposition wins adherence.

In this universe of human incertitude and error, there is one exception. While one must suspend judgment as much as possible concerning claims to truth by other human beings, one must surrender one’s judgments to what God himself has revealed for one’s salvation. Only in the realm of salvific truth, revealed by an omniscient God, can the human person discover a truth perfectly safeguarded from error. “As nothing is weaker and less reasonable than to submit one’s judgment to that of someone else, rather than using one’s own, nothing is greater and more intelligent than to blindly submit one’s judgment to God, by believing on His word everything that He says” (Maxim no. 1). This affirmation of the necessity of blind submission to God’s self-revelation bears the imprint of Jansenist fideism. Skeptical of the philosophical arguments for God’s existence proposed by neo-scholastic theologians as preambles to the act of faith, many Jansenist theologians argued that authentic knowledge of God’s existence and attributes can only be found through attentive reception of the scriptural portrait of God revealed by God himself. For Sablé, it is this revealed truth alone that bears the stamp of infallibility and that stands exempt from her skeptical scrutiny of claims to knowledge.

4. Interpretation and Relevance

The vagaries of the publication history of Madame de Sablé’s works indicate how easily the philosophical reflection developed by women in the early modern period can disappear. Frequently reprinted in the eighteenth century as part of anthologies, the maxims of Sablé were often ascribed to an anonymous author or to her two prestigious male colleagues, La Rochefoucauld and Pascal. Only in 1870 would Jouaust’s scholarly edition of the entirety of Sablé’s maxims correct the history of misattribution and properly restore the work to Sablé’s authorship. Victor Cousin, the preeminent French philosopher during the July Monarchy, championed a revival of interest in the marquise by the publication of his biography of Sablé (1859). This erudite work, based on archival research, featured the publication of previously unpublished Sablé writings, notably her treatise On Friendship and extracts from her correspondence. Cousin’s work, however, tends to dismiss the value of Sablé’s thought as it celebrates the personality of the paradigmatic salonnière. Cousin declined to publish the entirety of Sablé’s maxims on the grounds of their general mediocrity and their inferiority to the maxims produced by her protégé, La Rochefoucauld. A similar apologetic tone emerges in Jean Lafond’s commentary on the integral edition of Sablé’s maxims he presents in his popular edition of La Rochefoucauld’s Maximes et Réflexions diverses (1976). “If we present the maxims of Madame de Sablé here, it is not to suggest a comparison [with La Rochefoucauld] that would turn too often to the disadvantage of the marquise” (303).

The barbed remarks of Cousin and Lafond indicate a persistent problem in the interpretation of Sablé: the tendency to treat her as a La Rochefoucauld manqué. In this interpretation, Sablé’s piety, sentimental defense of love, and moderation in her critique of masked vice make her a pale version of the more radical critique of virtue and knowledge developed by La Rochefoucauld. This interpretation occults the originality of Sablé’s philosophical argument, however. It is disagreement, not timidity, that leads her to argue that mature friendship can be a locus for the exercise of authentic virtue and that La Rochefoucauld’s dismissal of all public virtues as hidden vices is wrong. Her claim that certain moral and religious knowledge can be obtained from divine self-revelation does not derive from a certain religious conventionality in the face of La Rochefoucauld’s skeptical dismissal of all claims to noetic certitude. Rather, it springs from her conviction, well honed through her Jansenist associations, that only such revelation-based propositions concerning God and the moral order can claim the unreserved assent of the noetic subject.

Only recently has Sablé emerged as a subject of philosophical, rather than literary, interest. Like other moralistes of early French modernity, the study of her works has been confined to literature rather than philosophy departments. But as with her fellow moralistes Montaigne and Pascal, the epigrammatic writings of Sablé treat issues of enduring philosophical interest. Her maxims develop concise arguments on the illusion of virtue, the nature of love, the sources of authentic religious knowledge, the relationship between power and knowledge, and the vices typical of a status-centered society. Her correspondence pursues philosophical questions central to a theology of grace in the company of preeminent philosophers of the period, such as Pascal and Arnauld. In her writings, the salon (the era’s central venue for the philosophical formation of women) becomes the subject of ethical analysis. It is the salon’s rituals of power, codes of politeness, and quest for scientific knowledge that provide the principal data for Madame de Sablé’s critique of the human pretension to virtue and to certitude.

5. References and Futher Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author.

a. Primary Sources

• Sablé, Madeleine de Souvré, marquise de. Maximes de Madame de Sablé in La Rochefoucauld. Maximes et Réflexions diverses, ed. Jean Lafond. Paris: Gallimard, 1976. Pp 227-247.
• Sablé, Madeleine de Souvré, marquise de. Maximes de Mme de Sablé 1678, ed. Damase Jouaust. Paris: Librairie des bibliophiles, 1870. (Available online at the Projet Gallica on the webpage of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.)

b. Secondary Sources

• Barthélemy, Édouard de. Les amis de la marquise de Sablé: recueil de lettres des principaux habitués de son salon. Paris: E. Dentu, 1865.
• Conley, John J. The Suspicion of Virtue: Women Philosophers in Neoclassical France Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2002. Pp 20-44.
• Conley, John J. “Madame de Sablé’s Moral Philosophy: A Jansenist Salon” in Presenting Women Philosophers, ed. Cecile T. Tougas. Philadelphia: Temple University Press, 2000. Pp 201-211.
• Cousin, Victor. Madame de Sablé: études sur les femmes illustres et la société du XVIIe siècle. Paris: Didier, 1859.
• Ivanoff, Nicolas. La Marquise de Sablé et son salon. Paris: Les Presses Modernes, 1927.
• Van Delft, Louis. “Madame de Sablé et Gracián,” Saggi e Ricerche di Letteratura Francese, 1983. 22: 265-285.

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University
U. S. A.

Joseph Priestley (1733—1804)

A notable Enlightenment polymath, Joseph Priestley published almost two hundred works on natural philosophy, theology, metaphysics, political philosophy, politics, education, history and linguistics. Remembered today primarily as a scientist who isolated oxygen, Priestley considered his calling to be that of a theologian, and he spent most of his life working as a minister and teacher. He combined his Unitarian theology with an associationist, materialist and determinist philosophy to create a coherent world-view that was the subject of bitter controversy.

The implications of his metaphysics were challenging. Priestley posited that matter, far from being impenetrable and inert, was subject to internal forces such as attraction and compulsion. This enabled him to assert that the matter of the brain is sensitive to certain vibrations that form the basis of thought. He went on to argue in favor of a material basis for the soul and its complete physical unity with the body. Priestley believed that perception, knowledge, intellect, and memory were acquired through sensory experience and that simple ideas combined into complex ideas through a process of association. This mechanism was entirely material and therefore based on necessary causal laws determined by God.

Priestley tended to prioritize the practical and the experimental above the purely theoretical. His metaphysical beliefs grew in part from his passion for natural philosophy and his careful scientific investigation. His understanding of the world was based on an assumption that truths were demonstrable and revealed through observation and experience. This included studying scripture alongside the natural world in order to gain knowledge of a God who orchestrated and determined all events for the ultimate good of humanity. Priestley was a “rational dissenter” whose careful biblical exploration allowed him to argue for the unity of God. Jesus was wholly human and did not die as an atonement for inherently sinful humanity, but lived to exemplify the perfect moral life that all people could potentially attain.

Priestley argued that the truths of scripture were available to all through the careful application of reason. This influenced his liberal political position, as he penned many works in favor of complete toleration and minimal governmental intervention. Priestley believed that the story of humanity was a march of progress towards ultimate perfection. Liberal government was one means by which truth could triumph in an atmosphere of free and unfettered debate. Priestley was also a fervent millenarian, trusting in biblical prophecy and waiting for the second coming of Christ, the ultimate aim of all human progress. This optimistic liberalism saw Priestley through a barrage of vitriolic criticism and the infamous “Church and King” riots which destroyed his Birmingham home in 1791. Despite the disappointments of the French Revolution and his forced emigration, Priestley stuck tenaciously to his belief in progress and Providence. A hopeful advocate of reason and rational religion, he died with the conviction that his physical resurrection and perfect life with Christ would not be long coming

Table of Contents

1. Biographical Sketch
   1. Religious Beliefs
   2. Education and Marriage
   3. Life as a Minister and Teacher
   4. Natural Philosophy
   5. Portrayal, Reception and Legacy
2. Theology
   1. Method
   2. Principal Ideas
      1. Unitarianism
      2. The Atonement
      3. Predestination
      4. Original Sin and Grace
      5. The Soul
      6. The Millennium
   3. Reactions and Criticisms
3. Politics and Political Philosophy
   1. Principal Ideas
   2. Priestley and the Law
   3. Toleration and the Pursuit of Truth
   4. Reactions and Criticisms
4. Association of Ideas
   1. Principal Ideas
   2. Links to Other Ideas
   3. Reactions and
5. 5. Matter and Spirit
   1. Principal Ideas
   2. Priestley, Newton and Boscovitch
   3. Theology
   4. Reactions and Criticisms
6. Philosophical Necessity
   1. Principal Ideas
   2. Links to Other Ideas
   3. Reactions and Criticisms
7. Philosophy of Education, History and Linguistics
   1. Principal Ideas
   2. History and Language
   3. Reactions and Criticisms
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Works
      1. Theology
      2. Politics and Political Philosophy
      3. Association of Ideas
      4. Matter and Spirit
      5. Philosophical Necessity
      6. Philosophy of Education, History and Linguistics
   2. General Secondary Sources
      1. Theology
      2. Politics
      3. Association of Ideas
      4. Matter and Spirit
      5. Philosophical Necessity
      6. Education

1. Biographical Sketch

Priestley’s childhood was marked by upheaval, rejection and spiritual doubt, while his education granted him considerable intellectual liberty and independence of thought. To understand these early years of rejection, isolation and freedom is a significant step towards understanding Priestley’s adult thought as earnest and rational but at times controversial, idiosyncratic and consistently misunderstood.

The following account of Priestley’s life is taken mainly from his autobiography.

Priestley was born on March 13th, 1733 at Birstall Fieldhead, a small village just southwest of Leeds where his family had lived and worked for several generations. His father, Jonas Priestley, was a wool-cloth dresser and his mother, Mary Swift, came from a farming family. Priestley was their first-born child, but three brothers and two sisters soon followed in quick succession. The demands of a large family meant that the young Priestley was sent first to live his grandfather and later, after the death of his mother, to the home of his childless uncle and aunt.

a. Religious Beliefs

Priestley recalls religious devotion on the part of his parents, his uncle and his aunt. However, while Priestley shared his family’s religiosity and remained a committed believer all his life, he was profoundly affected by early theological doubts. He tells us that he was “much distressed” because he could not “feel a proper repentance for the sin of Adam” and was equally disturbed by his failure to experience the “new birth” regarded as “necessary to salvation.” Having a weak constitution and facing death during adolescence, Priestley was faced with the “horror” of feeling that God had forsaken him (Autobiography 71).

It is fortunate that Priestley had the intellectual and spiritual resources to deal with these fears. Although a strict Calvinist, his aunt often entertained liberal Armenian and Baxterian theologians, so the young Priestley was able to explore the rational theology that would quell the horrors that haunted him. He was eventually able to view his doubts as part of his progression towards truth. He writes that his illness, rigorous religious upbringing and failure to experience a conversion allowed him to acquire a “serious turn of mind,” and his doubts were compensated by a rational understanding of God and proper action. However, as his theology drifted from that of his family and community, Priestley faced rejection and isolation. Priestley had grown up attending the Heckmondwike congregation and tells us that he desired to be admitted as a communicant. However, his membership was refused “because, when they interrogated me on the subject of the sin of Adam, I appeared not to be quite orthodox.” When Priestley adopted Arianism at Daventry it marked a break with the family that would not be reversed (Autobiography 73).

b. Education and Marriage

As a boy Priestley attended several schools in the local area and learned Latin, Greek and Hebrew. When his illness prevented him from going to school, he continued his education at home. These early years of self-education were marked with the seriousness, hard work and intellectual isolation that Priestley found so productive in later life. During these years Priestley taught himself French, Italian, and High Dutch “without a master,” while also learning geometry and algebra and reading the work of John Locke and Isaac Watts. In 1752 Priestley entered Daventry Academy, as his dissenting views prevented him from subscribing to the Westminster Confession and thus excluded him from the traditional universities. With young informal tutors and a liberal curriculum, Priestley found intellectual freedom and companionship and discovered the associationist ideas of David Hartley (Autobiography 70-75).

Priestley flourished at Daventry, enjoying the discipline and hard work and building “warm friendships.” In contrast to the rejection and isolation of his childhood, Priestley found himself part of a community of likeminded thinkers. As an adult he was to continue to find intellectual companionship with middle class dissenters and liberals, such as the Lunar society in Birmingham and his fellow tutors at Warrington. In 1762 he also married happily Mary Wilkinson (1743-1796), the daughter of the famous iron master Isaac Wilkinson, whose sons John and William continued to expand the family’s fortunes. He writes fondly although not passionately of Mary, calling his marriage a “very suitable and happy connexion” (Autobiography 87).

c. Life as a Minister and Teacher

Priestley graduated from Daventry in 1755 and moved to Needham Market, Suffolk, to work as a minister at the local chapel. It was not a happy time: lacking the financial assistance originally promised by his aunt, Priestley struggled for money and also struggled to be accepted into the community. No one came to the school he established and most were unable to accept his Arian theology.

Despite these problems, it was this combination of educator and minister that would keep Priestley employed throughout his life. In 1758 he moved to Nantwich in Cheshire and again took on a congregation and established a school. This time he was much more successful and his ideas were communicated and received with ease. In 1761 Priestley took up a tutorship in languages and belles lettres at Warrington Academy and again combined this with a position as a minister.

In 1767 Priestley left Warrington to become a minister for the Mill Hill Chapel in Leeds, a post with increased financial security, allowing Priestley to put the role of minister at the center of his life once again. In the county of his childhood Priestley was accepted by the liberal dissenting congregation where once he had experienced theological rejection. Of course, he also continued to teach and set up a series of classes of religious instruction for members of the chapel.

Suffering financially at Leeds, and keen to broaden his horizons, Priestley took up an offer to sail with James Cook to the South Seas as the ship’s astronomer. However, the arrangement fell through, and after toying with the idea of moving to the colonies, Priestley finally, in 1773, took up residence in Calne, Wiltshire, in order to work in a varied and ill-defined role as Lord Shelburne’s companion. Priestley was given a house for his growing family and a healthy salary; in return he acted as intellectual companion and political ally to Lord Shelburne. He practised many of his now famous experiments for Shelburne’s guests, took over much of the education of his children and considerably expanded the library. Priestley was thus able to continue his role as a teacher, but he preached only occasionally.

His life with Shelburne was never as successful as either party had hoped, and in 1780 Priestley left the service with a good pension to become senior minister of the New Meeting in Birmingham, a large, wealthy and influential congregation. Priestley seems to have been very content in this role of minister, which he continued to see as the most important activity in his life. He also taught children from the congregation and established a number of Sunday schools that taught reading, writing and mathematics as well as religious tenets. However, these happy times did not last long. Priestley left Birmingham after his house and belongings were destroyed in the notorious Church and King riots of 1791. He moved the family to Hackney where they stayed until 1794. He succeeded Richard Price at the Gravel Pit meeting as morning preacher. Increasingly well known as a liberal political philosopher and theologian, Priestley was elected a citizen of France but declined an offer to be a representative to the National Convention.

Priestley faced continuing pressure and the fear of further riots while he lived in London. Significantly, he had to obtain official notice that he was not evading arrest before he could emigrate to the United States in 1794 where he hoped to find freedom and tolerance in the new world. Priestley lived in Pennsylvania until his death in 1804 in a house built in Northumberland and shared with his son Joseph and his family. Mary Priestley and their son Harry both died during this time, and Priestley’s health slowly deteriorated. Priestley preached only occasionally in the following years but published much and continued to write until the day of his death, February 6th. That evening, although very ill, Priestley finished dictating some changes to some pamphlets. When these were complete he said “That is right; I have done now” and died just hours later (Autobiography 139).

d. Natural Philosophy

As a young teacher and minister in Nantwich, Priestley had acquired the basic apparatus needed for natural philosophy: an air pump and electrical machine used in lessons with the older pupils. As a tutor at Warrington, recently married, settled and part of a stimulating community, Priestley allowed his interest in natural philosophy to flourish.  After moving to Leeds Priestley continued to experiment with electricity and researched optics. Turning to pneumatic chemistry he published his Directions for Impregnating Water with Fixed Air in 1772.  The same year Priestley’s Observations on Different Kinds of Air was published in the Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society. The paper was significant—Priestley had isolated nitric oxide, anhydrous hydrochloride and acid gases. It also introduced the ideas of eudiometry and photosynthesis. In 1773 Priestley won the Copley medal from the Royal Society.

Priestley used the resources provided by Shelburne at Calne to continue his experiments in pneumatic chemistry and published many of his findings. He isolated samples of what we would now call ammonia gas, nitrous oxide, nitrogen dioxide, sulphur dioxide and most notably oxygen. He also continued to investigate refraction, heat expansion, sound transmission of gases and photosynthesis. Priestley’s scientific interests also found an outlet in Birmingham through his membership of the Lunar Society. Here he met many well-known scientists and businessmen including Erasmus Darwin, Josiah Wedgwood, Matthew Boulton and James Watt. Priestley also entered into a debate with Antoine Lavoisier about how best to interpret his experiments identifying oxygen.  He built a new laboratory and published more of his findings while living in the United States. Until his dying day, he stubbornly stuck to his phlogiston theory despite convincing arguments in favor of Lavoisier.

e. Portrayal, Reception and Legacy

Priestley was a man with a great deal to say but found it a struggle to speak and make himself understood. He stammered from early childhood, yet he followed a career demanding effective communication. His speech impediment caused him significant distress at school and at Daventry and contributed to his rejection at Needham where, he tells us, he found preaching “very painful” (Autobiography 80). Misunderstanding and miscommunication seem to be significant themes in Priestley’s life. The ideas that he saw as reasonable and pleasing to God were received as dangerously revolutionary both in politics and theology. Although he regarded himself as a rational advocate of truth who wrote according to the respectable precepts of the doctrine of candor, his adversaries called him arrogant and incendiary. He advocated political, religious and intellectual freedom and the pursuit of truth through unfettered debate, yet he could be stubborn and uncompromising and believed in absolute truth. This led him into heated controversy and acrimonious debate despite his insistence that he simply wanted a frank exchange of opinions. Priestley was portrayed by his enemies as a dangerous radical with a political and religious philosophy that would undermine the moral and social order. In print and in cartoon Priestley was “gunpowder Joe,” an explosive enemy of church authority, the truth of revealed religion and the political status quo.

2. Theology

We find a set of sophisticated religious and theological beliefs at the very heart of Priestley’s intellectual and moral life, his career and politics, his social networks, behavior and sentiments. To understand Priestley’s faith is to understand the central motivation for the majority of his published works.

a. Method

Priestley’s most striking contribution to theological debate was his approach to the study of Christian scripture. He was one of a small group of Unitarian thinkers who devised a new translation of the Bible with the distinguishing feature that it should be in a state of continual improvement. Priestley had confidence in the project because he held that although truth itself was absolute and uniform, human attainment of truth was a fluid and gradual process. Knowledge must not be allowed to stagnate, and there was much work still to be done. At the heart of this slow progression toward absolute truth was Priestley’s belief that all humanity could reach the perfect understanding attained by Christ.

Priestley argues that reason is a tool for the use of all humankind and that application of reason alone is enough to convince us of the existence of a unified, benevolent, creator God. The empirical evidences of natural religion and the precepts of rationality are God-given resources provided in order for us to understand the deity as a self-comprehending, omnipresent and omniscient being. However, other essential knowledge is not available through reason and natural religion alone. Revelation is also needed in order to teach us important lessons such as the proper use of prayer and other teachings of Jesus.

Priestley approached scriptural study extremely seriously because of the essential role of revealed religion. He tells us that rational evaluation of the Bible is the only way in which truth can be attained. He denounced all the mystery and irrationality of orthodox theology, denying the Trinity and the Atonement as examples of such muddled and disordered thought. Without mystery and without the need for unfounded faith the individual was free to interpret scripture by the light of reason. Only rational thought, good education and complete liberty of conscience were needed for understanding the words of revealed law in their plainest sense and as a coherent whole. This was open to all individuals who possessed the powers of reason and thus religious authority and the need for a clergy–seen by him as distant and elite–were undermined in one sweep.

Priestley also developed a critical method in his approach to scripture based on careful linguistic and historical study. He emphasized the highly figurative nature of the scriptures and argued that many misunderstandings were merely verbal, the result of taking ancient languages out of their cultural context. Furthermore, Priestley studied history in order to explain the ways in which Christianity had become corrupted over time as misunderstandings crept in, disfiguring the pure and simple beliefs of the early church.

b. Principal Ideas

i. Unitarianism

Application of his theological methods allowed Priestley to develop a set of religious beliefs which he regarded as highly rational and as close as possible to the pure Christianity of the early church. Already denying the Trinity, Priestley left Daventry Academy an Arian and tells us that it was after reading Nathaniel Lardner’s Letter on the Logos of1759that he adopted the Unitarian creed he held for most of his adult life. Priestley argued that the notion of the Trinity is an essentially irrational tenet of an unquestioning faith. It requires a willingness to replace individual reason with trust in the teaching of church authorities whose power is perpetuated by ideas shrouded in superstition and mystery. He compared this belief to the simple idea of a unified God, a rational truth present in both natural and revealed religion. His historical work allowed Priestley to argue that the early Christians and Church Fathers were Unitarian and that belief in the Trinity was a corruption that had crept into scripture over the centuries. The Trinity slowly developed over time as gentile and heathen beliefs infiltrated simple “pristine” understanding of the unlearned. The most important message of the Old Testament, argues Priestley, is that God is unified and indivisible. In the New Testament, while the role of Jesus is essential, the Father is entirely exclusive of the Son. He tells us that when scripture appears to say that the Father, Son and the Holy Spirit are equally divine, the language is highly figurative and should not be read literally. This leaves Jesus as wholly human and the powers he possessed as those granted by God to an ordinary man. Christ has the power for resurrection and ascension, but he is not God, according to Priestley. He is not divine and should not be worshipped, despite being an object of our utmost respect.

ii. The Atonement

Priestley undermined the divinity of Jesus and in doing so deeply altered the whole interpretation of his death and resurrection. Priestley insisted that the death of Jesus was only a sacrifice in the figurative sense. His death was not a means by which the wrath of God had been diverted, and his sacrifice was not an atonement for sin. Jesus was not a divine mediator between God and humanity; he was a savior simply because his life was a demonstration of perfect moral duty and the truth of physical resurrection.

iii. Predestination

Priestley argued that the Calvinist notion of predestination was irrational and had only a flimsy basis in scripture. Arguing from utilitarian premises, Priestley writes that God’s manifest plan is to produce the greatest happiness for his people; a system which condemns many to eternal torment and therefore produces exceptional misery cannot be part of this plan. Priestley was drawn to the idea of universal salvation, the only system to ensure the greatest happiness. He acknowledged the role of punishment as an important part of divine justice and even wrote that it should be long and severe in order to be effective. However, he could not accept that finite humans would be punished infinitely.

iv. Original Sin and Grace

The notion of grace that was prevalent among the clergy and orthodox believers was based on the idea of original sin pardoned by the death of Christ, a sacrifice for the sake of fallen humankind. Instead of believing in this idea of innate sinfulness and supernatural reconciliation, Priestley held that everyone had the potential to attain the perfect moral knowledge that Jesus had exemplified and taught. Part of this potential for perfection, writes Priestley, is that God has given us moral laws that we are perfectly capable of following. Although he concedes that everyday fallible humans are unlikely to be morally perfect, he contends that we can choose to lead a life pleasing to God and make constant effort to repent and change our behavior. He places this at the center of Christian life, rather than the emotional evangelical faith, the Calvinist “experience” or the fallacy of the death bed conversion. He tells us that it is not arrogance or pride which allows us to dismiss the idea of original sin and believe that all humankind can do what God tells us. It is simply the power that God has given to all of us. The idea that we are justified by faith or predestination diminishes this power that every person has to do the will of God.

v. The Soul

The metaphysical basis for Priestley’s disavowal of the existence of the soul is explored in the section of this article on “Matter and Spirit.” Priestley combined exploration of the nature of matter with scriptural study to argue for the unity of body and spirit, insisting on the biblical basis for a belief in physical resurrection. He writes that there is no scriptural basis for a split between body and soul. Not only is belief in the soul unreasonable based on the evidence around us, writes Priestley, it is also a belief which careful historical exploration shows was an idolatrous heathen tenet that crept into Christianity and slowly corrupted it.

vi. The Millennium

Priestley was a fervent millenarian, trusting in biblical prophecy and waiting for the second coming of Christ. He read widely on the millennium and placed himself within a well established scholarly tradition of millenarian study. Priestley was hopeful that he was living in the “last days” before the foretold return of Christ. Reading Daniel and Revelation, Priestley believed that the return of the Jews to their homeland would precede the glorious second coming and waited eagerly for such an event. He carefully watched worldwide political developments for signs that Christ’s rule on earth was soon to begin, and it is likely that looking for such evidence that the bible contained absolute truths and tangible proofs of the existence of the deity appealed to Priestley’s scientific mindset. The American Revolution seemed a good sign and his optimism intensified after the French Revolution and the Birmingham riots. At the end of his life Priestley became increasingly preoccupied with the millennium, putting a great deal of hope in the imminent arrival of Christ and studying scriptural prophecy in great detail.

c. Reactions and Criticisms

For Priestley there was an order, even a beauty, which stemmed from the process of obtaining truth through reason, and in the pure, rational and simple truth that this process revealed. Although his enemies called him “gunpowder Joe,” his grains of gunpowder were no more than a series of necessarilyrelated ideas which, when marshaled by strict reason and controlled by rational thought, would always have the same outcome. However, to some of Priestley’s Anglican opponents his reason-driven truth was subversive and seditious. He was accused of demolishing the foundations of revealed truth and, in consequence, of morality. They saw moral upheaval where Priestley saw rationality and order.

Contemporary reactions to Priestley’s theological and religious works often involved in-depth scriptural analysis. This kind of discussion has been seen as less relevant today. Some secondary comment has focused on the interaction between Priestley’s theological position and his political beliefs, often identifying interesting conceptual links. For example, J.C.D. Clark stated that theological heterodoxy and radicalism were ‘conceptually basic’ (281). A.M.C. Waterman has added to the debate, arguing that although challenging the Trinity is enough to undermine the principle of subordination in church and society, there is no necessary link between dissent and subversive politics (Haakonssen 214). Other comment has examined Priestley’s belief in miracles and biblical prophecy in light of his highly rational stance. For example, Martin Fitzpatrick asks us to consider whether Priestley’s obsession with apocalyptic texts in his later life was the sign of an unbalanced mind (Fitzpatrick 1991 106). However, Clark-Garrett argues that, far from a weakness or drift in old age, Priestley’s millenarian speculations were consistent with his overall outlook. His attention focused by the French Revolution, Priestley was simply using his scientific method to observe the unfolding patterns of Providence, and the fulfilment of prophecy was a key part of this search for facts and evidence to bolster his rational religion (53).

3. Politics and Political Philosophy

a. Principal Ideas

At the heart of Priestley’s political philosophy lie the twin themes of progress and perfectibility. His work is shot-through with an optimism that arises from his unswerving belief in progress and a perfect future state. Priestley’s work rests on an assumption that humankind will be better off in the future than it is at present and that society in the present is already more perfect than life in the past. Unlike brute animals who continue in the same way without change, human society is constantly in a state of development, change and improvement. He tells us of the happiness he experiences because of the realization that whatever the world was like at the beginning the end will be perfect and “paradisiacal.” Importantly, mankind’s unbounded potential for future development requires good government, and, going full circle, good government here means government conducive to progress.

Priestley conjectures a social contract to illustrate his ideas on liberty. He tells us of a group of unconnected individuals who lead separate lives. They are exposed to many wrongs and have few advantages. If the people voluntarily submit to join forces as part of a group they resign some of their natural liberty in return for protection, alliance and other advantages. Some liberty has to be given up just for the society to function. A large group of people would need representatives in order to make decisions on behalf of society and, although this may seem like a sacrifice of liberty, these men would act purely for the good of society and reflect the sentiments of the whole body. The only thing that gives them power is that they are there to act for the public good. Reason and conscience guide them and the people judge them.

Significantly, Priestley divides “natural” liberty into civil and political liberty after the contractual agreement. This is a distinction which Robert E. Schofield says was only commonplace after Mill and that Priestley felt was necessary for the sake of clarity (1997 210). Political liberty, Priestley tells us, is the power of holding or electing public office. It is the “right of magistracy,” the power of the private opinion made public. Civil liberty is the power an individual has over their actions and only refers to their own conduct. It is the right to be exempt from the control of others.  Priestley tells us that when natural liberty is resigned upon entering into society, it is civil liberty that is relinquished for the sake of increased political liberty.

Once elaborated, Priestley’s articulation of two types of liberty allows him to place his theory on utilitarian grounds. The good and happiness of the whole of society is made identical with the good and happiness of the majority of its members. Happiness, good and progress become inextricably linked within this theory, as Priestley had insisted that progress towards perfection is the ultimate goal for mankind and would result in unbounded happiness. He tells us that government is required to identify what is most conducive to progress, and therefore to happiness, and to eradicate barriers and limits to progress. For example, division of labor is useful and should be encouraged, as it aids the economy and increases knowledge. Specialization helps everyone reach their potential and means that the arts and sciences are likely to flourish. Meanwhile, progress is hindered by encroachments on civil liberty. Priestley was concerned that progress would stagnate if education and religion were not left free to flourish and reach perfection. He wrote against established religion and against state education, wary of uniformity and unnecessary authority. He insisted that diversity of opinion was essential for free debate and ultimate progress and therefore advocated complete religious liberty and freedom of speech.

b. Priestley and the Law

Although Priestley celebrated freedom and was concerned to limit government intervention for the sake of individual liberty, he did not have an antagonistic opinion of the law. Good government plays an important role within Priestley’s philosophy, protecting liberty and rights but also serving as an active agent of change. Priestley’s political philosophy has a psychological foundation based on the doctrine of association. Human perfection was to be achieved along associationist lines. Good government and society was crucial to this process. Government should explore what circumstances are most conducive to progress and happiness and apply these principles, even if this means intervening or limiting freedom to some extent.

c. Toleration and the Pursuit of Truth

Priestley’s theology and his status as a dissenter informed much of his political work. At a political level Priestley was keen to speak on behalf of rational dissent and outline the political principles most often associated with Protestant dissent in general. Eager to inform the Anglican clergy of the political opinions to be found amongst their dissenting counterparts, Priestley writes that there is no reason to assume that dissenters are anarchists or republicans. The vast majority are peaceful, law-abiding and property-owning. He tells us that dissenters respect human authority in most matters, respect the government and support the Hanoverian succession. However, they do not recognize human authority in religion, seeing no spiritual or scriptural reason for church authority or established religion. The church has no business in civil government, and one of the many reforms required was a full separation of church and state, as well as a purging of other popish ways still left within the Church of England.

At a philosophical level, Priestley’s demands for religious liberty were often for utilitarian reasons, recognizing the need for liberty in order to foster truth and aid progress. He was skilled in illustrating these abstract arguments with numerous historical examples to consolidate his case. Priestley did believe firmly in the absolute nature of divine truth, but he argued for full toleration for dissenters, Catholics and even atheists. This was because at the root of his call for toleration was a powerful conviction that to uncover divine truth should be the ultimate aim of all human endeavors, and this needed an atmosphere of free and unrestrained debate. Rational dissent held that truth arose from the application of human reason and conversely that unnecessary intervention could be extremely harmful. If laws were in place that stifled free discussion and forced belief in superstition or falsehood, the cause of truth was left in the dark

d. Reactions and Criticisms

Priestley’s Essay on the First Principles of Government went swiftly through two editions and continued to be published throughout the nineteenth century. Clearly influential at the time, the work also had significant long-term impact. Jeremy Bentham acknowledged the Essay as the inspiration for his utilitarian “greatest happiness” principle. Although Bentham’s famous words do not appear anywhere in the work of Priestley, it is fair to say that this is a significant legacy. However, in his own time, Priestley’s work was met with criticism and attack. Priestley backed the campaign for the repeal of the test and corporation acts, and this provoked a huge conservative backlash fuelled in part by heightened reactionary fears following the French revolution. In this heated atmosphere, accusations of sedition and treason were common currency, and Priestley came under serious criticism for his political and theological views. Priestley’s critics entangled religion and politics and made little attempt to identify Priestley’s own first principles. Priestley was accused of attempting to undermine the authority of the church and the government. His political philosophy seemed dangerously egalitarian and his insistence on continual progress was a dangerous threat to the old order. Priestley’s insistence on the importance of unfettered individual reason had dangerous consequences. His enemies explicitly stated that Priestley’s concern for the truth had inverted the order of things. Priestley had destroyed the necessity for a separate Clergy and attacked the sacredness of their profession. By questioning the need for obedience and asserting the authority of the individual, it seemed to nervous minds that he had inverted the whole social hierarchy.

One way this division has manifested itself is in the interesting relationship between natural law and utility as it appears in Priestley’s political philosophy. For example, both Margaret Canovan and Robert Schofield comment on the relationship as it appears in Priestley’s Essay on the First Principles of Government (Canovan 1984, Schofield 1997 209). Schofield suggests that Priestley’s brand of utilitarianism is significantly less relativist than Bentham’s. While Bentham used the happiness principle as the only guiding force of government, Priestley never doubted that there was a perfect way of governing and that it was towards this that mankind should progress. Canovan also questions the idea that Priestley was a proto-Benthamite. She says that the underlying assumptions of the two men are significantly different. Priestley firmly believed in the existence of a benign and all powerful God who presided over a well-ordered and structured universe. So it was in this realm of natural law that Priestley’s utilitarianism was supposed to operate. Priestley believed in the existence of an objective moral order so while happiness for Bentham could be whatever society or any individual decided it should be, happiness for Priestley was universal, fixed and could be evaluated in moral terms. While Bentham constructed a moral order from utilitarian grounds, Priestley simply used the principle in order to evaluate and discern moral laws. This places Priestley firmly in the natural law tradition. It allows him to use the language of rights as part of his political philosophy without compromising his utilitarianism.

The real extent of Priestley’s liberalism is debated in a variety of different ways in the secondary literature. For example, Martin Fitzpatrick has highlighted that, while Priestley supported toleration whole-heartedly, this was because of his conviction that absolute truth would eventually prevail, rather than the pluralistic outlook of Richard Price (1982 18-23). Margaret Canovan has pointed out that, although Priestley is rightly remembered as a liberal, he often celebrated a paternalistic view of class relations (1983). Celebrating the bourgeois station, he stressed the importance of middle class charity to the poor, which would encourage their ambition and create useful social bonds. He also wrote that inequalities were part of God’s plan for the present, despite his general support for social mobility. Isaac Kramnick has also pointed out this ‘ominous’ side to Priestley’s liberalism, examining the new layers of authority Priestley was prepared to impose on society in the name of progress and reform. Kramnick argues that the scientifically minded Priestley viewed the state as a kind of laboratory where intervention was required to perfect humankind, and so his thought is shot-through with a regard for authority and discipline (11, 20-22).

4. Association of Ideas

a. Principal Ideas

The principle of association states that ideas are generated from external sensations. Complex ideas are made up of simple ideas. These complex ideas are formed through repeated juxtaposition or “association” over time. This means that ideas become united in the mind so that one idea will be invariably followed by the other.

Hartley tells us that this principle has not escaped the notice of writers both ancient and modern but that it was John Locke who affixed the word “association” to the theory. Locke had argued that ideas are not innate but derived from experience. In mechanistic terms he explained the ways in which simple ideas become associated in experience and therefore build up complex ideas. Locke had posited a mind blank before experience of sense impressions had made their mark.  Hartley picked up this idea and added to it a physiological basis for the associationist theory, an idea that it was vibrations acting on the brain that laid down ideas and that when two vibrations occurred simultaneously over time they become associated in the mind. Hartley used Locke’s epistemology but removed Locke’s emphasis on reflection as a means to knowledge. Locke had written that all knowledge is based on sensation and then reflection. Hartley simply said that all types of ideas were derived from sensation. Priestley followed Hartley and dropped Locke’s need for reflection as a distinct source of knowledge. Priestley also read the Rev. John Gay who had used Locke’s associationist principle to argue against the innatist theory of morals of Francis Hutcheson. Gay had argued that morality and the passions were acquired through experience; as we attempt to avoid pain and seek pleasure our morals and passions are formed.

Enjoying debate and finding creativity in opposition, Priestley expounded his most coherent theory of association as an attack on the notion that innate common sense can stand above reason when it comes to religious belief. Published in 1774 Priestley’s Examination of Dr. Reid‘s Inquiry…Dr. Beattie‘s Essay…and Dr. Oswald‘s Appeal is a harsh and rigorous refutation of common sense in favor of association. Like Hartley, Priestley was keen to make association the sole basis of human understanding. Hobbes had written of association as one means that certain ideas become linked by resemblance or causality. In contrast to Hobbes, Locke was more interested in unnaturally associated ideas, or when two things that have nothing in common end up united. However, for Priestley association was the foundation and excluded all other epistemological sources. This certainly ruled out what he took to be Reid’s theory, that sensations are made into ideas by innate principles implanted by God, and it excluded the argument that sensations act on the passive matter of the brain and that innate instincts act to turn them into knowledge. Priestley writes that living is about experience. That something seems instinctive does not mean that it has not derived ultimately from external experience.

b. Links to Other Ideas

Associationism allowed Priestley to identify the general laws of human nature he was looking for and is therefore the basis for much of his metaphysical, educational and political writing, as well as informing his theology. For example, Priestley’s work on the nature of matter enabled him to add a physiological basis to the doctrine of association. Once association was understood physiologically Priestley was able to argue against Cartesian dualism, against the existence of an immaterial soul, and in favor of the material unity of body and mind. In his political and educational philosophy the doctrine of association furnished Priestley with a means by which circumstances could be understood to shape the intellectual and moral life of individuals. This allows for progress in society and in the acquisition of knowledge because it allows for controlled change through experience. It gives teachers and legislators the power to shape others through altering circumstances or environment. Association consolidated Priestley’s determinist doctrine of philosophical necessity as it allowed all actions to be traced back to motives and ideas formed entirely from experience and therefore potentially determined by Providence. Finally, association also appears in Priestley’s theology. In the Institutes of Natural and Revealed Religion (1772) Priestley explains that revealed religion has followed the same pattern historically as an individual does when learning through association. The development from the Old Testament to the New is like the process of acquiring knowledge of pain and difficulty but also love of god and the pleasures of life as an individual.

c. Reactions and Criticisms

Priestley’s devotion to the doctrine of association was one of the less controversial aspects of his thought. The system was already part of a respected tradition and Priestley’s ideas were not especially innovative or shocking. However, the polemic feel of his attacks on Reid, Beattie and Oswald did provoke some sharp replies and Priestley actually issued an apology for the tone he had struck. Robert E. Schofield has argued that Priestley played a crucial role in maintaining Hartley’s ideas, especially among the utilitarians, and therefore had an important influence on the nineteenth century. While late nineteenth-century associationist psychology is often regarded as the precursor to the behaviorism of the twentieth century, studying Priestley allows us to locate the ideas considerably further back (2004 52).

5. Matter and Spirit

a. Principal Ideas

Priestley wanted to elucidate a physiological theory to refute his interpretation of the Scottish “common sense” system of separate instinctive perceptions. Priestley writes that all sensations are the same. They arise from experience as vibrations in the brain. Priestley argued that this system offered a simplicity that the theory of separate and original instincts could not. An outside stimulus causes the brain to vibrate. For example, “seeing” is actually the result of vibrations of the optic nerve caused by light. Vibrations consisted of tiny movements of small particle, of the nerves and then of the brain. These movements were caused by the impressions made by external objects on any of the five senses.

Priestley tells us that all matter vibrates and that all matter can transmit these vibrations to our brains.  Following Hartley, Priestley tells us that once the brain has been made to vibrate a trace of that vibration is left behind. Hartley calls this a “vibratiuncle.” Although Priestley cuts down on such technical terms the theory is the same. A “vibratiuncle” is laid down as a tendency for the brain to vibrate the same way again. If the initial vibration was strong or intense, then so too will be the vibratiuncle. If the vibration is weak or small, then the vibratiuncle too is weaker. If the vibration occurs many times, this has the same affect, strengthening the trace and increasing the tendency to vibrate. When two vibrations occur together they act on each other or modify each other so that, as they occur repeatedly together, they become associated in the brain. This association means that when one occurs the other will also occur. Vibrations can build up sets of vibratriuncles so that if only one vibrates, the others in the system will vibrate too. One occurrence triggers all of them.

This is the physiological basis of the associationist doctrine. It explains how sensations become ideas and how simple ideas can build up into complex ones through this process. While Hartley did acknowledge the parallel process between ideas and physiological vibrations, he was keen to leave room in his theory for the existence of an immaterial soul. Priestley lacked his caution and was driven to question the means by which a non-physical substance could act upon a physical one. While Hartley had left this a mystery and posited an “elementary substance” that was neither matter nor spirit but linked them both, Priestley’s answer was to abandon any kind of dualism at all. He writes that our understanding is troubled simply because of the way in which matter appears to us. Superficially it seems solid and inert. However, Priestley tells us, experiments reveal that this is not the case. Matter is far from solid or impenetrable, it is made up of atoms and particles and these are subject to forces of attraction and repulsion depending on their arrangement. It is these forces that make matter seem solid. Matter had been assumed to be incapable of thought or perception because it was solid and not affected by outside forces. It was seen as inert, sluggish even, and therefore incompatible with the capacity for sensation. Now that this assumption had been undermined, it remained entirely possible that matter could form the basis for our mind and spirit as well as physical being.

When the matter of the brain was subject to vibrations and vibratriuncles, it was engaged in thought. Priestley does not tell us how vibrations become ideas. He admitted that, although he did not know how material substances think over and above this basic supposition, he argued that the possibility remained and that this scenario seemed more likely than the existence of separate and immaterial soul. The distinction between matter and spirit was therefore unnecessary and untrue. Priestley writes that his materialism leaves fewer questions unanswered than the notion of a soul. It prevents the need for speculation about how and why the soul leaves the body and how it may return, what happens to the soul before resurrection and how a soul comes to choose a certain body to start with. Priestley claimed he had resolved the problems of Cartesian dualism and the tricky distinction that had corrupted Christianity. He had redefined the nature of matter and made the composition of the body single and uniform.

b. Priestley, Newton and Boscovitch

Priestley’s regard for Newtonian theory is communicated strongly in his works on matter and spirit. Robert E. Schofield has explained the ways in which Priestley’s career can be seen as dedicated to the Newtonian idea of matter (1964 291-294). At the end of principia mathematica,IsaacNewton gives us a physical explanation for the association of ideas. Unlike John Locke, who was wary of looking for a physical basis of his idea of association, Newton used a theory of vibrations to explain how perception and memory are formed. Hartley then relied on Newton’s idea of an elastic ether and the possibility for vibrating motions to occur within it. In the same way, it was Newtonian ideas about matter, that “solids” retain an impression when vibrations or forces act upon them, that allowed Priestley to explain the lasting affect of vibrations on the matter of the brain. Furthermore, it was Newton who had suggested that objects in the world cause light sensations which vibrate the optic nerve and allow us to “see,” and it was a Newtonian desire to uncover simple, universal laws of explanation that linked Priestley’s ideas on association and matter and spirit so neatly.

c. Theology

It is impossible to separate Priestley’s metaphysical opinions about matter and spirit from his theology. His speculations on the nature of matter provided Priestley with scientific and physiological evidence to deny the existence of the soul. Some thinkers insisted that matter was inert and animated only by a God-given soul. Priestley’s matter was different. It was not inert. Matter was complex and active. It was possible for the brain to be wholly material and also to vibrate and therefore to “think” rather than a passive vehicle moved by an immaterial soul. When Priestley examined the atheism of Baron d’Holbach he stated that it was one of the most convincing arguments he had come across. This was because d’Holbach shared some of his ideas on the nature of matter. However, d’Holbach held that forces of attraction and repulsion, gravity and electricity were simply the “energy of nature.” Priestley said that this was another name for God, an energy which should be acknowledged as having intelligence and design. His continued faith meant that Priestley never relinquished scriptural study and examined the Bible in relation to his understanding of matter.

Priestley’s reading of scripture convinced him that the idea of soul was actually a “corruption” of Christianity and that resurrection, when it occurred, was of a physical and not a spiritual nature. He attacked the dualism of Descartes but argued that the idea of an immaterial mind and soul was actually of ancient pagan origin, having crept into Christian belief and undermined “monist” Hebrew doctrines. His opinion on the material nature of the soul allowed him to explain the resurrection of matter and spirit as a single, material event.  Priestley argues from scripture alongside his exploration of matter. He writes that the idea of the soul only appears in some badly interpreted and unconnected passages of the bible and that, if such duality had actually been part of God’s design, it would have been revealed with clarity. Priestley insisted that removing this corruption from our understanding of scripture would strengthen the foundations of revealed religion and lead to stronger, rational, belief. While the notion of the soul had debased the whole idea of resurrection, Priestley believed his materialist ideas explained the process by which the body would die and decompose, only to be recomposed and physically restored to immortality through the power of the divine.

d. Reactions and Criticisms

Robert E. Schofield has shown evidence that Michael Faraday had read Priestley and claims that British scientists showed so much interest in Boscovichian atomism because Priestley had advocated his ideas (2004 71-72). Boscovich’s own reaction was more typical. He was absolutely furious that Priestley had reduced his ideas to materialism. Other commentators were similarly outraged. Priestley’s edition of Hartley came under severe criticism and his further publications on the subject heightened the controversy. Materialism was feared by many; it could easily slip into atheism. The theological speculations that accompanied Priestley’s metaphysics were regarded with suspicion and met with outright anger.

Joseph Berington, a Roman Catholic, and the Anglican Bishop Samuel Horsley both penned fierce refutations of Priestley’s works on the nature of matter and spirit. His ideas provoked vitriol from a wide variety of believers. A respectful debate with Richard Price reveals the extent to which Priestley’s ideas were a challenge even to other rational dissenters. Price refused to agree that matter was not inert. For him, matter was solid and could not be imbued with sensation or perception. Matter was subject to forces such as gravity but only because God had added these properties onto matter; they were not innate. Price argued strongly in favor of the existence of the soul. He said that although he did not see the body as something corrupt and something that trapped the soul, he did think that there was an immaterial part of the body and that this needed a link to the physical body in order to exercise certain powers. He saw two separate substances connected and dependent but distinct. Priestley’s engagement with such a diverse selection of critics served to ensure that his views on matter and spirit would become infamous and added to his reputation as an idiosyncratic, controversial and even dangerous figure.

6. Philosophical Necessity

a. Principal Ideas

Priestley writes that he published his principle work on philosophical necessity out of concern for the ambiguous definitions of liberty and necessity. He tightened the meaning of these words and argued that, under the system of philosophical necessity, everyone is free; everyone is entirely at liberty to do anything they will as long as there are no external constraints. So all people can think whatever they chose and act however they chose. However, everyone is also operating under divine necessity. Everyone is bound by causal laws fixed by God and directed by him for the ultimate good of all humanity. This means that there is no way that two different events, decisions or acts can occur when the circumstances are exactly identical. Provided the circumstances are identical, there is only one possible outcome. This removes any possibility for random occurrences and eliminates all chance. No room is left for the possibility of variation. Everything becomes part of an entirely determined chain of causes and effects.

Priestley asserts that when most people examine their views on free will, they will see that those ideas actually fit better into his system of philosophical necessity than they immediately realize. Once liberty and necessity are properly understood, he writes, they are actually compatible with each other. It is chance or randomness that is incompatible with freedom or voluntary action. Priestley puts it in terms of motives for acting. He says that throughout nature there are fixed, unalterable laws. David Hume had said that every cause and effect is just a conjunction; the connection could be arbitrary. The cause and effect may appear to be linked, but there is no way of knowing for sure that they are. Priestley, on the other hand, was keen to refute Hume. He said there is an invariable connection between cause and effect. Furthermore, in the case of human choice and action, the cause is often a motive. If one has a state of mind and then acts, the same action will occur again if the state of mind is unaltered. The choice made is voluntary, but the motives that led to that choice form part of an unbroken necessary chain of causes and events.

Priestley also discusses the role of God within this system in more detail. He tells us that God knows everything, but he would not be able to foresee contingent events–this alone eradicates the possibility of contingency and consolidates Priestley’s determinist position. Aware of the controversial conclusions of this position, Priestley admits that this means that God is the author of sin. However, as God determines everything for the ultimate good, vice and bad behavior are in fact part of a greater divine plan to bring humankind to perfection. Priestley was careful to distinguish this system of necessity from the predestination of Calvinism. Calvinists held that God uses supernatural methods in order to bring about change and chooses an elect few for salvation. Priestley’s God worked naturally through a string of necessary causes and effects only, and although sinners would be punished, Providence did not allow for eternal damnation.

Priestley’s ideas on determinism and providence were not new. He cites Hobbes and Hartley as major influences, as well as drawing from Locke and Hume. What is more interesting here is the extent to which these ideas were part of a personal journey for Priestley. He tells us that it is his happiness to find a resolution to his anxieties that motivated him to publish on the subject. The security and satisfaction that comes from contemplating every event as part of the divine plan of Providence gave Priestley his characteristic optimism and self-assurance. It was this that he was keen to make known to the public.

b. Links to Other Ideas

Philosophical necessity works well with Priestley’s idea of matter. Priestley had insisted that the human body and spirit were both physical. As matter is subject to the universal or unchanging laws of nature, it follows that no decision in the mind or act in the body can be random or spontaneous.

Philosophical necessity and the association of ideas are also closely related. Priestley acknowledged the importance of human will and the sense that this was free. Association explained how the will was created. All motives were part of a causal chain of associated ideas. Basil Willey has argued that it is the associationist foundation of philosophical necessity that means it promotes moral behavior (171-174). Priestley posited a universe created by God in which vice is less attractive than virtue in terms of the rewards it brings. Although physical pleasure and sin bring short term benefits, it is more compelling in the long term to follow a virtuous path. According to his system, it is possible for people to change their motives and their circumstances and therefore to alter their behavior for the positive. This suffuses the necessarian doctrine with human agency. It means that humankind cannot simply sit back and let Providence take its course. We may be instruments of God, but in understanding that our own motives and choices are part of a chain of cause and effect, we can act to alter them and become more virtuous. Although all events are determined and God is the ultimate author of sin, on a day-to-day level we have freedom to shun vice and chose virtue. Unlike God, humankind does not have the power to use sin and wrongdoing for the sake of good, and therefore we must chose to live virtuous lives.

Finally, understanding philosophical necessity is important in order to get to grips with Priestley’s notions of reward and punishment. Priestley spends a lot of time writing about the ways in which necessity is the only system that allows punishment to make rational sense. A person acts because of a set of motives, these are caused by circumstances. Therefore circumstances and motives can be altered. There is no reason to punish behavior is if it not caused and not based on a rational intention

c. Reactions and Criticisms

Priestley entered into a number of debates concerning his determinism including a long and respectful debate with Richard Price. Price argued that free-will was essential in order to ensure that we take responsibility for our choices and actions before God. He added that a determined system was less of an achievement of creation than the reality of human freedom God had granted. Priestley was aware of the accusation that the system of philosophical necessity removed any imperative towards moral behavior. Although he tried to address this by arguing that on an everyday level all people can chose to act or not to act. He used his associationist theory to explain that people could actively change their circumstances in order to alter their motives over time. Most contemporary and modern commentators have pointed out that this has the feeling of a clever paradox. Robert E. Schofield calls it “sophistry” and Basil Willey has pointed out that the liberty granted to humankind under Priestley’s system of philosophical necessity is free will under a different name (Willey 171-174, Schofield 2004 79).

7. Philosophy of Education, History and Linguistics

a. Principal Ideas

In his educational works, Priestley tells us that the education provided at dissenting academies and universities is often ill-suited to the young men in attendance. The curriculum provided did not prepare them for a civil and active life. He emphasized that the traditional subjects, such as philosophy, mathematics and logic, were important but could not alone fit a young mind for work in anything but the clergy and learned professions. Instead he wanted to educate a generation that was destined for a life of commerce and for magistrates, lawyers, powerful merchants, statesmen and even the landed. The broad liberal education that Priestley recommended was to turn out useful liberal minds from among the middle classes and included modern history, law, economics and the arts. He also turned his attention to women, refuting the notion that they were intellectually inferior and arguing that many women would need to subsist alone and should be given the tools to do so. Women were moral creatures just like men, and as education was the basis of morality their exclusion was counter to Priestley’s hopes of progress and perfection. Priestley’s attitude to the education of the poor was less enthusiastic. His liberalism meant that he stood against state education but did not extend his interest in a more positive direction.

Priestley’s educational philosophy was based on his metaphysics. It is a fine example of the ways in which he brought associationism, materialism and philosophical necessity together in practical ways. Priestley thought that all knowledge, intellect, perception and memory were acquired through sensory experience and that simple ideas combined into complex ideas through association. This mechanism was entirely material and therefore based on necessary causal laws which could be identified and manipulated. It was important because any two ideas could be associated together to control the environment of children so that they were exposed to the most useful and virtuous associations. Denying any chance that knowledge or morality is innate put extra emphasis on the importance of environment, especially when minds were young and malleable and the potential for progress and perfection was at its peak.  Priestley’s optimism now had a practical outlet. It was up to the educator, whose actions had a sole and necessary effect on children, to prepare the next generation for virtue and improvement that could be unlimited.

Priestley was careful to prepare a curriculum which would optimize healthy physical, moral and intellectual development, and this meant using the theory of association to design learning aids and make practical recommendations. Association meant that the most useful learning involved natural discussions and digressions and that experience rather than theory was always to be more memorable. Priestley’s ideal lessons involved question and answer sessions and group discussions. Both sides of a controversy were to be understood and all queries and objections brought to light. Priestley was keen on the use of mechanical aids in teaching, such as his successful charts of history and biography. He wanted to convey knowledge in an ordered and regular manner so that it was easily learned and remembered.

b. History and Language

Priestley made significant contribution to the development of a modern curriculum. His philosophical work was enriched by his experience as a teacher. Priestley put together a philosophy of history and a linguistic theory while preparing lectures for publication. For Priestley, history was a useful practical tool. It appealed to him because it could be used to demonstrate God’s divine purpose and could be observed in order to understand political and economic developments more fully. Priestley writes that history is like the experiments made by the air pump or electrical machine. It demonstrates the workings of nature and God and therefore provides the foundations for theoretical speculation. Like personal experience, history was a swifter teacher than abstract ideas. It allowed one to assemble the evidences of the divine plan and unveiled the plans of Providence. History could increase our understanding of God and the ways in which he used short-term suffering for the greater good; that which appeared evil was actually essential for progress and would terminate in the perfection of humanity.

Priestley hoped that to view history in this way would increase virtue and piety in the minds of his pupils and infuse all with a sense of optimism. He also wanted to encourage his students to see history as a laboratory, where all manner of political systems had been tried and tested. It provided the data needed for sound political philosophy. A liberal government, unfettered thought and belief and free trade could be seen historically to stimulate progress. Furthermore, accurate study of all aspects of the past, from domestic lives to warfare, would increase knowledge of humanity and therefore help future advancements. This meant that Priestley advocated the study of modern history including arts, language, food, clothing, manners and sentiments. He extended the number of sources traditionally seen as relevant to historical study to include material evidence such as coins, medals, inscriptions, fortifications and town plans.

Alongside history Priestley had a long standing fascination with linguistics, and over the course of life as a teacher developed a coherent philosophy of language. He stressed the importance to teaching language and insisted his student be well educated in the vernacular. He tells us that English is as vital as Latin, adding that it is a serious defect in any gentleman not to be able to read and write well in his own language. Priestley made a number of contributions to the study of English grammar, and his influence in the field extended well into the nineteenth century. As part of his grammatical work, Priestley highlighted the importance of understanding that language is in a continual process of development and that the only really useful standard by which to establish rules of language was to look at custom and usage.

These observations were part of a broader theory of language development. Priestley tells us that language is human, not a direct gift from God. It grows up slowly as words gain meaning through association, first simple words and then more complicated constructs. It develops slowly and irregularly and its symbols are arbitrary and often subject to changes of use and meaning. This means that, in order to translate accurately and fully understand the languages of the past, careful cultural study is needed in order to furnish us with enough information to understand meaning and usage. Individual language acquisition to some extent mirrors this process. Young children grasp the meaning of words through constant association between object and word. Furthermore, Priestley tells us that the association of ideas is important for understanding the impact of language, especially figurative language, on the mind. Words can trigger whole strings of associations based on both cultural and individual experience.

c. Reactions and Criticisms

Priestley’s publications on education were generally well received at the time and ran into many editions. Modern commentators, however, have highlighted concern that Priestley used his status as a historian and educator to propagate his Unitarian theology. Arthur Sheps says that history was often written for “pugnacious and apologetic” reasons and that being a historian was a way of gaining moral authority. Priestley gained a historical reputation and was then able to use it to provide evidence for his scriptural exegesis (Belleguic 149). John McLachlan goes even further. He sees Priestley as someone whose religious belief overruled his more rational pursuits. He let a hopeful optimism in the workings of Providence get in the way of careful historical thinking (260).

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

i. Theology

Priestley’s first religious publications grew out of his role as a teacher of youth while employed as a minister at Leeds. In 1767 he published A Catechism for Children and Young Persons and followed this in 1772 with A Scripture Catechism, consisting of a Series of Questions, with References to the Scriptures instead of Answers. Although these early works were intended to lay down the basics rather than spark doctrinal controversy, hints of Priestley’s unorthodox views creep through the conventional veneer. In 1772 Priestley published his Institutes of Natural and Revealed Religion, a long and detailed exposition of the central beliefs of rational dissent, drawn from a variety of rational and liberal theologians. Many of Priestley’s works contain a similar emphasis on summarizing and streamlining the views of other thinkers, such as A Free Address to Protestant Dissenters on the Subject of the Lord‘s Supper (1768) and Considerations on Differences of Opinion among Christians (1769).These formed part of a plethora of publications answering his already fierce critics, and Priestley continued to court controversy when he published An Appeal to the Serious and Candid professors of Christianity in 1770. Many answers and many replies followed, and the same opinions were repeated in Familiar Illustration (1772).

In 1768 Priestley established the Theological Repository,a theological journal with lofty aims to further truth through unfettered and candid debate. This allowed Priestley to rewrite some of his now familiar arguments under a variety of pseudonyms, while his long-running series of Letters to a Philosophical Unbeliever gave him space to challenge the views of those whose faith had been lost through the reading of modern philosophers. With strong leaning towards historical modes of arguments and an interest in the history of early Christianity, Priestley published his 1777 A Harmony of the Evangelists, in Greek,followed by a version in English in 1780. Other important historical studies include Priestley’s History of the Corruptions of Christianity,first published in 1782, and An History of Early Opinions concerning Jesus Christ in 1786. In the 1790s and following his emigration, Priestley continued to defend his heterodox opinions on the Trinity with his Defences of Unitarianism series and the 1795 Unitarianism Explained and Defended, and he showed an increasing interest in biblical prophecy and the impending millennium, for example in his 1794 The Present State of Europe Compared with Antient Prophecies.

ii. Politics and Political Philosophy

In 1768 Priestley published his Essay on the First Principles of Government. Widely read and well regarded, the Essay was Priestley’s first political publication. The following year Priestley published a pamphlet, The Present State of Liberty in Great Britain and her colonies, which reiterated many of the concerns grappled with in the Essay. 1769 also saw the publication of three works dealing with Protestant dissent, each addressed to liberal dissenters themselves or intended to inform others about their principles. In 1787 Priestley again entered political terrain with An Account of a Society for encouraging the Industrious Poor,in which his liberal individualism was more than obvious. Many of Priestley’s political publications are evidence of the close link between his politics and theology. In 1769 he published Considerations on Church Authority, A View of the Principles and Conduct of Protestant Dissenters and A Free Address to Protestant Dissenters as such,all of which highlight the influence of Priestley’s theology on his political philosophy. Priestley also wrote on religious liberty in An Address to Protestant Dissenters… on the Approaching Election of Members of Parliament and overviewed current arguments in favor of toleration for his patron Lord Shelburne in 1773. In 1780 Priestley controversially came out in favor of toleration for Roman Catholics, and again stirred up trouble a decade later by entering the vitriolic debate on the repeal of the Test and Corporation Acts, with letters to Pitt and Burke and a defense of his opinions addressed to the people of Birmingham.

iii. Association of Ideas

We first encounter Priestley’s associationist opinions in his Institutes of Natural and Revealed Religion, which he began writing while still at Daventry and published in three volumes between 1772 and 1774. The Institutes and a number of later publications on the same topicinclude an attack on the principles of the common sense philosophy of Oswald, Reid and Beattie. The theme is continued in Priestley’s edition of Hartley’s Observations on Man in 1775, where Priestley cut out much of Hartley’s work on physiology and theology in order to concentrate solely on expounding the doctrine of associationism.

iv. Matter and Spirit

David Hartley had vigorously denied accusations of materialism, but Priestley’s own monist views emerged first in his edition of Hartley’s Observations on Man in 1775. Although he removed some of Hartley’s physiological exploration and theological concerns, Priestley appended a number of essays to his edition of the work that took Hartley’s doctrine of vibrations and its materialist implications much further than the author would have liked. In 1777 Priestley set out to elucidate and defend his ideas on the unity of body and soul in his Disquisitions relating to Matter and Spirit,causing further offense and controversy. The following year, Priestley engaged in an exchange with Richard Price in which he defended his view of matter as capable of thought and perception and his disbelief in the existence of a nonphysical soul.

v. Philosophical Necessity

Priestley’s interest in the determinist philosophy he called “philosophical necessity” emerges first in his Institutes of Natural and Revealed Religion,where Priestley’s utilitarianism entails the direct intervention of a divine Providence in order to ensure that all suffering is ultimate good and the unhappiness of a few will always benefit the majority. The doctrine also plays a crucial part in his Examination of the Scottish common sense philosophers and his Disquisitions…. In 1777 Priestley outlined and defined these ideas in a work dedicated to the system, the Doctrine of Philosophical Necessity Illustrated.

vi. Philosophy of Education, History and Linguistics

Priestley’s ideas on education emerge first in his Essay on the First Principles of Government, which actually took form out of his remarks on a well known code of education. In 1765, while working as a tutor at Warrington, he published a major work, the Essay on a Course of Liberal Education. In 1778 the Miscellaneous Observations Relating to Education outlined this syllabus in detail. In his 1788 Lectures on History and General Policy,Priestley’s thoughts on education are elucidated with clarity and, along with his published syllabuses, lectures and teaching aids, the work allow us valuable insight into his educational philosophy. Priestley also produced teaching aids: a Chart of Biography in 1765 and New Chart of History in 1769, which used timelines to illustrate the major figures and time periods in history. Some of Priestley’s earliest publications were about language and grew from his post as tutor of languages and belles-lettres at Warrington. In 1761 Priestley published The Rudiments of English Grammar,and this was followed a year later by A Course of Lectures on the Theory of Language and Universal Grammar. Priestley was an influential grammarian, and his publications were widely read and well received; he is notable for his emphasis on custom and usage as the most useful standards by which to assess correct language. In 1777 his Course of Lectures on Oratory and Criticism explored rhetoric, style and taste, introducing the importance of psychology and human nature as the means by which to understand these aspects of language.

b. General Secondary Sources

• Priestley, Joseph. Autobiography of Joseph Priestley. Bath: Adams and Dart, 1970.
• Schofield, Robert E. The Enlightenment of Joseph Priestley: A Study of his Life and Work from 1733-1773. Pennsylvania: The Pennsylvania State University Press, 1997.
• Schofield, Robert E. The Enlightened Joseph Priestley: A Study of His Life and Work from 1773-1804. Pennsylvania: The Pennsylvania State University Press, 2004.
• Truman Schwartz, and John McEvoy, eds. Motion toward perfection: The Achievement of Joseph Priestley. Boston MA: Unitarian Universalist Association, 1990.
• Willey, Basil. The Eighteenth-Century Background. Harmondsworth: Penguin, 1962.

i. Theology

• Brooks, Marilyn. “Priestley’s Plan for a Continually Improving Translation of the Bible.” Enlightenment and Dissent 15 (1996): 89-106.
• Clark, Jonathan C.D. English Society, 1688-1832: Ideology, Social Structure and Political Practice during the Ancien Regime. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.
• Fitzpatrick, Martin. “Joseph Priestley, politics and ancient prophecy.” Enlightenment and Dissent 10 (1991): 104-109.
• Fruchtman, Jack. “The Apocalyptic Politics of Richard Price and Joseph Priestley: A Study in Late Eighteenth-Century English Republican Millennialism.” Transactions of the American Philosophical Society 4 (1983):
• Garrett, Clarke. “Joseph Priestley, the Millennium and the French Revolution.” Journal of the History of Ideas 34. 1 (1973): 51-66.
• Haakonssen, Knud, ed. Enlightenment and Religion: Rational Dissent in Eighteenth-Century Britain. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.

ii. Politics

• Canovan, Margaret. “Paternalistic Liberalism: Joseph Priestley on Rank and Inequality.” Enlightenment and Dissent 2 (1983): 23-37.
• Canovan, Margaret. “The Un-Benthamite Utilitarianism of Joseph Priestley.” Journal of the History of Ideas 45. 3 (1984): 435-450.
• Fitzpatrick, Martin. “Toleration and Truth.” Enlightenment and Dissent 1 (1982): 3-31.
• Kramnick, Isaac. “Eighteenth-Century Science and Radical Social Theory: The case of Joseph Priestley’s Scientific Liberalism.” The Journal of British Studies 25. 1 (1986): 1-30.

iii. Association of Ideas

• Bowen Oberg, Barbara. “David Hartley and the Association of Ideas.” Journal of the History of Ideas 37. 3 (1976): 441-454.
• Faurot. JH. “Reid’s Answer to Joseph Priestley.” Journal of the History of Ideas 39. 2 (1978): 285-292.
• Kallich, Martin. “The Association of Ideas and Critical Theory: Hobbes, Locke, and Addison.” ELH 12. 4 (1945): 290-315.

iv. Matter and Spirit

• Schofield, Robert E. “Joseph Priestley, the Theory of Oxidation and the Nature of Matter.” Journal of the History of Ideas 25. 2 (1964): 285-294.
• Schofield, Robert E. “Monism, Unitarianism and Phlogiston in Joseph Priestley’s Natural Philosophy.” Enlightenment and Dissent 19 (2000): 78-90.
• Laboucheix, Henri. “Chemistry, Materialism and Theology in the Work of Joseph Priestley.” Price-Priestley Newsletter 1 (1977): 31-48.

v. Philosophical Necessity

• Fitzpatrick, Martin. ” ‘In the Glass of History’: The Nature and Purpose of Historical Knowledge in the Thought of Joseph Priestley.” Enlightenment and Dissent 17 (1998): 172-209.
• Harris, James A. “Joseph Priestley and the ‘Proper Doctrine of Philosophical Necessity.” Enlightenment and Dissent 20 (2001): 23-44.
• Hatch, Ronald B. ” Joseph Priestley: An Addition to Hartley’s Observations.” Journal of the History of Ideas 36. 3 (1975): 548-550.

vi. Education

• Belleguic, Thierry ed. Representations of Time in Eighteenth-Century London. London Ont.:  Academic Printing and Publishing,1999.
• McLachlan, John. “Joseph Priestley and the study of History.” Transactions of the Unitarian Historical Society 19. 4 (1990): 452-463.
• Watts, Ruth. “Joseph Priestley and Education.” Enlightenment and Dissent 2 (1983): 83-100.

Author Information

Elizabeth Kingston
Email: e.s.kingston@sussex.ac.uk
University of Sussex
Great Britain

Deshoulières, Antoinette du Ligier de la Garde (1638—1694)

A major poet during the reign of Louis XIV in France, Madame Deshoulières used her writings to defend philosophical naturalism. Like her intellectual model Lucretius, she employed verse to argue that natural causes can adequately explain such apparently spiritual phenomena as thought, volition, and love. In metaphysics, Deshoulières argues that the real is comprised of variations of matter and that material causation adequately explains observed changes in the real. In anthropology, she claims that the difference between animal and human is one of degree, not of kind. Material organs, and not the occult powers of a spiritual soul, produce such human phenomena as thought and choice. In ethics, she insists that such instincts as self-preservation govern the virtuous activity customarily ascribed to an elusive free will. In particular, she emphasizes that the human phenomenon of love, endlessly debated in the salons she frequented, owes far more to instinctual attraction and repulsion than rationalist philosophers would admit. A friend and disciple of Pierre Gassendi, she constructed a distinctive chapter in Renaissance naturalism and in its struggle against the philosophical alternatives of Aristotelianism and Cartesianism.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. Works
3. Philosophical Naturalism
   1. Metaphysics
   2. Anthropology
   3. Critique of Virtue
   4. Environmental Ethics
4. Interpretations and Relevance
5. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Antoinette du Ligier de la Garde was born into an aristocratic Parisian family on January 1, 1638. Her father Melchior du Ligier, sieur de la Garde, occupied a prominent position in court circles as a chevalier de l’ordre du roi. He served as maître d’hôtel for Queen Anne of Austria, the wife of Louis XIII, and performed important services for the queen mother Marie de Médicis, the regent of France.

Even by the standards of the court aristocracy, Mademoiselle du Liger de la Garde’s early education was unusually sophisticated. She learned Latin, a rare achievement for a woman of the period, as well as learning Spanish and Italian. She studied the fashionable novels of La Calpranède, Urfé, and Scudéry, though she would later dismiss the novel as an inferior species of literature. Through her tutor Jean Hesnault, Du Ligier de la Garde became a partisan of philosophical naturalism. A disciple of Pierre Gassendi, Hesnault argued that all human action, like all movement in the cosmos, could be explained by physical causes. The tutor allied his metaphysical naturalism to religious skepticism (which is opposed to the thesis of the immortality of the soul), and also to ethical libertinism, which celebrated the rational pursuit of pleasure as the supreme moral good. Hesnault deepened this apprenticeship of naturalism by guiding Du Ligier de la Garde’s reading of the major texts of Gassendi and of the classical Latin philosopher Lucretius.

In 1651 Du Ligier de la Garde married Guillaume de la Fon-de-Boisguérin, seigneur Deshoulières. By all accounts, the marriage was an aristocratic alliance of convenience that permitted the spouses to pursue separate lives. A military officer attached to the Prince de Condé, Seigneur Deshoulières was embroiled in the Fronde (1648-1653), the intermittent civil war that pitted the French throne against dissident aristocrats, led by Condé. During the beginning of her husband’s war-related exile in the Lowlands, Madame Deshoulières studied philosophical works at her parent’s home in Paris. Her renewed study of Gassendi confirmed her allegiance to the philosophical naturalism she had imbibed from Hesnault.

In 1656, Madame Deshoulières joined her husband in exile in Belgium. Due to her persistent efforts to obtain the back pay owed her husband, she was imprisoned at the chateau of Wilworden in 1657. After a daring rescue by her husband, the couple fled to France, where they received a personal pardon from Louis XIV. Their reintegration into French society was quickly followed by the collapse of their marriage. In 1658, Seigneur Deshoulières successfully sued for a permanent separation of goods and persons. Declaring bankruptcy, he consigned his few remaining assets to his creditors. An impoverished Madame Deshoulières faced a grim social future in the anomalous position of a woman who was neither single, divorced, nor truly united to her legal husband.

Despite her penury, Deshoulières began her literary ascent in 1658 when she began to conduct a salon in her modest apartment on the Rue de l’Homme armé in Paris. The salon quickly attracted a coterie of authors noted for their libertinism: Benserade, Des Barreaux, Ménage, Quinault, Pellisson, and La Monnoye. In 1662, she published her first poem: a portrait of the skeptic Linières. An influential arbiter of literary disputes, she defended the modernist party in the querelle des anciens et modernes over the comparative merits of classical and contemporary French literature. A partisan of Corneille, she led an ill-fated campaign against the drama of Racine.

In 1672 Deshoulières published her first nature idyll in Le Mercure galant. Acclaimed as a poet of the first rank, Deshoulières published a flood of poetry during the next two decades. Her works explored the theme of nature and man’s immersion in it. Many of her more philosophical poems demonstrated how physical instinct is the cause of the intellectual and volitional activity philosophers wrongly attribute to a spiritual soul. Her poetry dealing with flora and fauna denied a substantial difference between human beings and other species of the organic world. In recognition of her literary achievement and philosophical prowess, the Academy of the Ricovrati of Padua (1684) and the Academy of Arles (1689) elected her to membership. Despite being banned from membership due to her gender, Deshoulières received recognition from the Académie française. During the inauguration of Fontenelle as a member in 1691, Académie officials recited poetry of Deshoulières as part of the official proceedings. Louis XIV granted her an annual pension of 2,000 pounds in 1688, consecrating her status as one of the nation’s leading authors.

In 1682, as Deshoulières showed the first symptoms of breast cancer, her poetry become more austere. Her older pastoral poetry yielded to a more abstract analysis of the characteristic virtues and vices of human nature. Toward the end of the decade, Deshoulières reverted to the Catholic faith of her youth. Her final poems, paraphrases of psalms in the Latin Vulgate, renounced the skeptical views of her earlier years and refuted a materialist explanation of human spiritual activity.

Madame Deshoulières died from cancer on February 17, 1694.

2. Works

First published in 1687, the collected poetical works of Madame Deshoulières demonstrated her literary dexterity. Deshoulières wrote in multiple literary genres: ode, idyll, ballad, madrigal, rondeau, portrait, maxim, biblical paraphrase, comedy, tragedy, and opera libretto. Immensely popular throughout the eighteenth century, her poetry underwent twenty distinct editions until the final edition of her complete works in 1810. The odes, pastorals, and satires no longer charmed a literary public avid for the more bombastic fare of Romanticism.

Anthologies of French poetry routinely include several of Deshoulière’s poems as exceptional specimens of neoclassical nature idylls. Many literary critics have noted the philosophical skepticism that permeates Deshoulières’s poetical exploration of nature. Antoine Adam’s argument is typical: “She [Deshoulières] had the reputation of being foreign to all religious belief and her poetry seems in fact to carry the reflection of this incredulity.”

The philosophical reception of Deshoulières has been less consistent. In the decades following her death, Deshoulières was acclaimed as a bold philosophical thinker who prepared the path to the religious skepticism of the Enlightenment. In his influential Dictionnaire historique et critique (1696; 1702) Pierre Bayle discusses the skepticism of Deshoulières concerning human immortality: “It is certain that anyone who spoke this way literally would be denying the immortality of the soul. But to save the honor of Madame Deshoulières, let’s just say that she was following certain poetical conventions we are not supposed to take too seriously—not that one can’t hide a good deal of libertinage under the privilege of versifying.” Veiled in his characteristic irony, Bayle’s judgment clearly pegs Deshoulières as a libertine skeptic. In their respective correspondences, both Voltaire and Rousseau praise the work of Deshoulières.

Subsequent history of philosophy has largely ignored Deshoulières. Just as her antiquated genres of expression closed her work to literary audiences after the French Revolution, her non-treatise style of argument masked the philosophical nature of her work. Only in the recent feminist expansion of the philosophical canon has the properly philosophical nature of Deshoulières’s work imposed itself anew.

3. Philosophical Naturalism

In the poetry written until her reconversion to Catholicism, Deshoulières defends a comprehensive philosophical naturalism. Her metaphysics conceives the world as an interactive network of atomically structured bodies. All phenomena, including the human phenomena traditionally interpreted as spiritual, could be explained in terms of material causation. Her theory of human nature denies a substantial difference between human beings and nonrational animals. The alleged human differences, such as the power of intellection and volition, for her suggest the comparative inferiority of human nature. Her ethical theory claims that alleged moral virtues are in fact the outcroppings of physical instincts. Deshoulières’s naturalism is normative as well as descriptive. The complete immersion of the real (which includes the human person) in nature demands a respectful treatment of the natural environment.

a. Metaphysics

The clearest expression of Deshoulières’s naturalistic metaphysics is found in her early work, “Imitation of Lucretius.” Faithfully following De Rerum Natura by the Roman poet and philosopher Lucretius, Deshoulières depicts the universe as founded on a simple, original principle of matter. “The order of an extrinsic cause/ Makes, by invisible moves,/ Enter into the form of various bodies/ All the sympathy described by academics.” This material principle of the cosmos requires a divine being, or an uncaused cause, to bring it into existence. Once matter exists, however, its internal principles and activities account for the subsequent evolution of the universe. This matter already has present within it the attraction and repulsion (“the sympathy”) that will create, destroy, and alter the various bodies that will proceed from this material matrix.

This vitalist material cosmos is an atomic one. “Imitation of Lucretius” explains how the atomic structure of the universe and of the discrete bodies that emerge from this universe causes change through the charged interaction of the atoms. “These atoms conjoined with the light,/ By their extreme fluidity,/ Are always in communion/ With the governing essence.” Just as the entire universe experiences flux through the dynamic interaction of its material parts which undergo the rhythm of attraction and repulsion, each distinct body represents a microcosm where change occurs through alteration of internal atomic structure due to incessant encounters with external bodies.

In Deshoulières’s metaphysics, the human person is not exempt from this network of material causation and atomic change. Like other bodies in the cosmos, human beings emerge from and are governed by the same principle of matter. “In a cyclone of subtle matter/ Placing them everywhere in inequality,/ The entire human race is the blessed offspring./ Its multiplicity rises to infinity.” Deshoulières insists that the allegedly spiritual powers, and not only the physical traits, of the human person can be explained by this material causation. The activity of thought is caused by the functioning of the physical organ of the brain, not by the impulses of an elusive spiritual power called reason. “The more one examines, the more one digs/ Into the confusion of what is true,/ Where particular individuals move in every way,/ It is evident that our organs, rather than our reason, figure things out.” Careful examination of human intellectual activity reveals its dependence on and origination in the physical organs of the body, preeminently in the brain. “Imitation of Lucretius” repeatedly appeals to the “envelope of matter” as the sole principle which explains the actions and changes of the embodied beings (including human beings) which populate the cosmos.

The naturalist metaphysics of “Imitation of Lucretius” indicates Dechoulières’s adherence to the atomic vitalism of Lucretius and Democritus. It also indicates a more radical cast of naturalism in comparison with that of her mentor Gassendi. Whereas Gassendi affirmed the existence of an immortal human soul specially created by God in light of the Beatific Vision, Deshoulières only briefly affirms the existence of a god necessary for the initial creation of matter. Once matter exists, its internal principles and activities are the unique cause for the existence and constitution of all subsequent beings, including human beings in their entirety. For Deshoulières, the real is coterminous with material nature, even if this nature has a decidedly lyrical character due to its fundamental dynamic of attraction and repulsion.

b. Anthropology

In her poetry, Deshoulières explores the relationship of human nature to the enveloping material nature of the cosmos. As she compares human beings to other animals, she insists that the allegedly spiritual activities of human beings can be explained by physical causation. Rather than being superior to other animals, human beings are actually inferior, inasmuch as they claim to possess a reason and freedom that are in fact illusory. The mute obedience of other animals to natural instinct compares favorably with the human propensity to self-destruction in trying to create a future that vainly attempts to alter the laws of nature. Traditional claims concerning human reason, free will, and immortality are subjected to critical scrutiny.

The nature idyll “The Sheep” (1674) criticizes the faculty of reason, which philosophers often exalt as the sign of human spirituality. In actual exercise, reason appears to be subordinate to the senses and the instincts possessed by all members of the animal kingdom. This distinctively human power appears impotent when challenged by the arational forces of passion. “This proud reason about which they make so much noise/ Is not a sure remedy against the passions./ A bit of wine disturbs it; a child charms it./ Ripping apart a heart that calls it for help/ Is the only effect it produces./ Always important and severe,/ It opposes everything but resolves nothing.” Deshoulières allies her critique of the claims of human reason to epistemological skepticism. For all its vaunted power, reason habitually leads to uncertain conclusions. Emotions govern the vacillating activity of reason far more powerfully than philosophical defenders of the light of reason would admit.

Like reason, free will is constructed on an illusion concerning the difference between human and animal natures. For Deshoulières, perfect freedom is found in following natural instinct rather than eluding it in fantasies of alternatives to natural causation. The nature idyll “The Birds” (1678) explains how authentic freedom is found in fidelity to natural instinct. “Little birds that charm me!/ You want to love? You love./ You dislike some place?/ You go to another./ You are known neither for virtue nor for faults…There is no freedom except among animals.” Authentic freedom consists in the capacity to follow one’s natural impulse. The praise of the birds’ freedom to love at will suggests the libertinism of Deshoulières’s intellectual milieu.

Later in the poem, Deshoulières explains that the only true obstacles to freedom are physical ones, such as the fowler’s net. Human freedom, the chimera of free will that produces “virtues and faults,” is illusory. Human agents claim to exercise free will to create a future that could have been otherwise. In actual fact, natural causation dictates future outcomes that cannot be altered by human wish. Deshoulières’s critique of free will as a human illusion rests on a deterministic theory of action that interprets human acts, as well as animal movements, as the product of physical causes.

In the same poem, Deshoulières extends a similar critique to the human phenomenon of love. Rather than being specific to human beings and rooted in the human possession of a will, love exists among all animals in their various expressions of attraction and repulsion. For her, the entire physical universe is built upon this amatory structure. “If Love were not mixed into this change [of the landscape from winter into spring],/ We would see all things perish. Love is the soul of the universe. As it triumphs over the winters,/ Which desolate our fields by a rude war,/ It banishes the chill from an indifferent heart.” Rather than being limited to the realm of the human psyche, love governs the entire movement of atoms as they effect change in the cosmos. The affectivity of the human heart is not superior to the physical forces that surround it. Like the seasonal changes of the cosmos, alterations in human temperament are directed by the play of external natural powers.

The illusory exaltation of the intellect and the will is rooted in a false conception of the human soul. “Ode to La Rochefoucauld” (1678) contests the theory of a human soul that would exist independently of the body. Deshoulières insists that everyday experience clearly demonstrates the interpenetration between body and soul. “Although the soul is divine,/ Invisible connections unite it to the body./ Does the soul have some bitterness?/ The body beats itself and consumes itself/ And shares its anguish./ Is the body a captive of pain?/ The soul no longer feels joy./ It itself weakens as the body does.” The strict parallel between the mental state and physical state in the human person indicates the identity between soul and body. The thesis of a spiritual soul existing independently of the body is rejected as an illusion, and is contradicted by the empirical evidence of the soul’s reciprocal dependence on the body.

In many passages, Deshoulières draws the explicit conclusion that the human individual cannot be immortal from her denial of a transcendent human soul. She argues that the psyche of the human person is governed more strictly by the laws of material nature than most philosophers of the period would concede. “The Flowers” (1677) compares the inevitable death of the human person to the extinction of flowers after a brief existence. In both cases, the death undergone is total. “Sad reflections! Useless wishes [of immortality]!/ When once we cease to be,/ Lovely flowers, it is forever. One fearful instant destroys us without exception.” While human beings might experience a metaphorical survival after death as “a faint memory of our names conserved by our society,” this mnemonic after-life is clearly not the survival of the personal soul. In Deshoulières’s demythologized account of human nature, the denial of personal immortality is the most radical of her efforts to demonstrate the complete circumscription of human nature within material nature.

c. Critique of Virtue

In criticizing the human pretension to superiority over nature through its alleged possession of reason and free will, Deshoulières devotes particular attention to the human claims of moral virtue. In her later works, she operates an umasking of virtue as the simple operation of natural instinct. What is often claimed to be a moral attribute developed by free will is revealed to be the natural reaction of an embodied subject to particular stimuli in his or her material environs. Her epigrammatic “Diverse Reflections” (1686) typifies this demythologization of virtue. She critically analyzes three moral virtues in particular: wisdom, prudence, and courage.

Philosophers often claim that wisdom is acquired by human beings as they age. This virtue is alleged to be the fruit of careful reflection on alternative courses of action. Unlike the rashness of youth, this cautious thoughtfulness frees the elderly to abandon certain dangerous habits that compromise their health. According to Deshoulières, however, this enlightenment is more instinctual than intellectual. “We believe we’ve become wise/ When, after having seen the autumnal fall of leaves more than fifty times,/ We abandon the dangerous use of certain pleasures./ We delude ourselves./ Such changes are not the work of free choice./ It is only the pride cloaking humanity/ Which, using every pretext/ Gives to the cause of virtue/ What we owe to the cause of aging.” As the human body ages, with the concomitant risk of illness and accident and the growing risk of death, the human agent instinctively moderates the use of dangerous drink or food or sport. This instinctual moderation owes far more to biology than to any deliberate choice. The alleged virtue of the elderly derives more from the natural reaction of the body to the threat of destruction, than to some mysterious internal act of election.

Similarly, the capstone moral virtue of prudence is little more than the instinctual exercise of common sense in the face of imminent peril. The alleged virtue might permit the moral agent to foresee danger but in and of itself it can not remove that danger. The common estimate of prudence gravely exaggerates the power of human reason and will to create the future. “The incense we give to prudence/ Leads my mood to despair./ What is its purpose? To see in advance/ The evils we must endure./ Is it such a benefit to predict them?/ If this cruel virtue had some certain rule/ That could remove them from us,/ I’d find the worries it gives bearable enough,/ But nothing is so misleading as human prudence./ Alas! Almost always the detour it takes/ In order to help us avoid a looming misfortune/ Is the path that takes us right to it.” Like the praise of other alleged virtues, the esteem for prudence overestimates the scope of human agency. While the human agent can detect dangers in its immediate environment, it can do little to alter that environment since it is bound by the laws of material nature, and so its future course is largely determined by the causative activity of that nature.

The cardinal moral virtue of courage is similarly dismissed as the product of sensible self-protection rather than of heroic freedom. Deshoulières attacks the courage of classical pagan warriors often lauded in the pedagogical literature of the period. The politically motivated suicides of disgraced civic leaders in the classical era are a predictable response to an unbearable physical and emotional environment. “We scarcely recognize ourselves in discussions of courage/ When we elevate to the rank of the generous/ Those Greeks and Romans whose suicidal deaths / Have made the name of courage so famous./ What have they done that is so great? They left life/ When, after crushing disgrace, Life had nothing pleasant left for them./ By one single death they spared themselves a thousand.” The suicide of a disgraced politician awaiting imminent arrest and probable execution reflects rational self-interest rooted in the instinct for sparing oneself greater pain than immediate death. There is nothing particularly surprising nor meritorious in executing such an act. In the circumstances, it could not have been otherwise.

In her demythologization of virtue, Deshoulières manifests the comprehensive scope of her naturalist conception of human nature. Virtue and vice, allegedly the manifestations of free will, are simply the instinctual reactions of the moral agent to the stimuli of pain and pleasure in his or her environment. Prudence, courage, temperance, and justice permit one to negotiate the perils in one’s surroundings in the interest of self-preservation. The repertory of virtue is not different in kind from the various defensive responses to threatening stimuli evinced by the other members of the animal kingdom as they confront the challenges of the material cosmos.

d. Environmentalist Ethics

Deshoulières’s philosophical naturalism includes a deontology (or ethics of duty) as well as a metaphysics. It is not anachronistic to claim that Deshoulières defends an environmentalist ethics. The total dependence of humanity upon nature requires the human agent to treat the material environment with respect. A properly naturalistic concept of human nature emphasizes the duty to reverence the cosmos that is humanity’s sole origin and end. Conversely, a rationalistic exaltation of humanity as set over and above material nature by dint of its allegedly superior reason justifies the subordination and destruction of nature.

In Deshoulières’s primitivist account of history, humanity reverenced nature in the first stages of its development. Ancient gathering societies respected the material world they gently used for their rustic lifestyle. “Ode to La Rochefoucauld” evokes this environmentalist golden age. “In that happy country when without prejudice/ Morals were permitted to run freely,/ Humanity was not avid/ For riches and honors./ It lived on wild fruit,/ Slept under open-air blankets,/ Drank in a clear stream./ Without goods, without rank, without envy/ It entered the tomb/ As it entered life.” This primitive humanity in tranquil communion with nature possesses its own politics. It is an egalitarian as well as frugal society. Its spontaneous moral life free of the constraints of social prejudice contains Deshoulières’s habitual libertine accents.

In modern society, technology has turned humanity into nature’s enemy. The human enterprise of land clearage, farming, dams, mines, and canals has disfigured material nature. “The Stream” (1684) argues that human exaltation of its allegedly superior reason has justified this domination and destruction of nature. “It is humanity itself that tells us that by a just choice/ Heaven placed, when it formed human beings,/ the other beings under its laws./ Let us not flatter ourselves./ We are their tyrants rather than their kings./ Why do we torture you [the streams]?/ Why do we shut you up in a hundred canals?/ And why do we reverse the order of nature/ By forcing you to spring up into the air?” The error of rationalism in refusing to see humanity as a part of nature is not a purely theoretical one; by exalting humanity as a rational being superior to the rest of nature, it has justified the human destruction of the environment as a species of moral good. This critique of environmental destruction also reflects Deshoulières’s religious skepticism. Clearly alluding to the Book of Genesis’s account of the divine grant of dominion over nature to humanity, the ode argues that it was human pride rather than divine inspiration that created such theological justifications for environmental destruction.

Deshoulières proposes that justification for the destruction of nature through an appeal to an illusory superior human reason has taken dangerous political and religious forms in modern society. “The Stream” criticizes the political claim to human rights since such a claim often justifies the human mutilation of nonhuman material beings that do not allegedly possess such rights. “Do not brag to me about these imaginary goods,/ These prerogatives, these rights/ Invented by our pride.” Similarly, the theological claim that human beings are made in God’s image justifies the destruction of other creatures allegedly not made in the divine image. “The more I see the weakness and malice of humanity,/ The less of the divinity/ I recognize in its image.” Rather than enhancing human dignity and human moral conduct, the claim of imago Dei actually increases human violence since it justifies the destruction of the material environment in the name of the ontological superiority of the human.

4. Interpretation and Relevance

Critical commentary on the works of Deshoulières has tended to highlight two strands of her philosophy. Earlier philosophical analysis (Bayle) underlined her religious skepticism, in particular her denial of human immortality. Recent literary exegesis (Adam, Lachèvre) has dwelt upon her libertinism. This approach has focused on the neo-Epicurian justification of the pursuit of pleasure and the avoidance of pain as a central ethical code in her works. It has noted her ethical theory’s critical distance from traditional Christian morality, especially in matters of sexuality.

The limitation in these approaches lies in their relative lack of attention to the broader naturalist metaphysics of Deshoulières. Her religious skepticism is grounded on the metaphysical conviction that the real is nothing other than the movement of material substance, structured in atomic patterns. All claims of spiritual substance, with the possible exception of an aloof deity who provides the initial matter, are illusory. The claims for the existence of an immortal human soul are part of a greater error concerning the nature of reality itself. Similarly, her moral libertinism is rooted in a naturalist conception of human nature. Since all mental activity is an epiphenomenon of corporeal activity, specifically in the brain, moral action rightly focuses on the preservation and care of the body. The maximization of pleasure and the reduction of pain thus becomes an imperative moral duty for the human individual and community. Her neo-Epicurean moral principles rest on the naturalist thesis that human nature is entirely immersed within the web of material nature and that claims of human transcendence due to a spiritual soul are erroneous. One of the challenges for contemporary exegesis of Deshoulières is to excavate the naturalist metaphysics in which her theological skepticism and utilitarian ethics are embedded.

Another challenge for contemporary analysis and appreciation of Deshoulières’s philosophy lies in the arcane genres in which she expresses her theories. Like other philosophical salonnières of the period, Deshoulières does not use the standard academic genre of the treatise to state her claims concerning metaphysics, anthropology, and ethics. If Lucretius’s poetic version of philosophical argument can challenge the contemporary student of philosophy, Deshoulières’s bewildering variety of poetical genres can overwhelm. The pastoral, the ode, and the idyll no longer have currency in literary circles, let alone in academic philosophical circles who determine the shape of the philosophical canon. Patient literary analysis of these antiquated forms is the necessary complement to a philosophical exploration of Deshoulières’s comprehensive naturalism. Behind the quaint quatrains of the shepherds stand a substantial environmentalist metaphysics and ethics.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

• Deshoulières, Antoinette du Ligier de la Garde. Oeuvres de Madame et de Mademoiselle Deshoulières, 2 vols.(Paris: H. Nicolle, 1810).
  • A digital version of this edition is available online at Gallica: Bibliothèque numérique on the webpage of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.
• Deshoulières, Antoinette du Ligier de la Garde. Poésies de Madame Deshoulières (Paris: Mabre-Cramoisy, 1688).
  • A digital version of this edition is available online at Gallica: Bibliothèque numérique on the webpage of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.

b. Secondary Sources

• Adam, Antoine. Les Libertins au XVIIe siècle (Paris: Buchet/ Chastel, 1986).
  • Adam studies the libertine milieu of Deshoulières and her colleagues.
• Bayle, Pierre, Dictionnaire historique et critique (Rotterdam: R. Leers, 1697).
  • Bayle discusses Deshoulières’s skepticism in the articles “Hesnault” and “Ovid.” A digital version of this book is available online at Gallica: Bibliothèque numérique on the webpage of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.
• Conley, John. The Suspicion of Virtue: Women Philosophers in Neoclassical France(Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 2002): 45-74.
  • The author analyzes and critiques the naturalism of Deshoulières.
• Lachère, Frédéric. Les derniers libertins (Paris: E. Champion, 1924)
  • Lachèvre discusses Deshoulières’s salon as the link between the skepticism of Montaigne and the free thought of the Regency.
• Perkins, Wendy. “Le libertinage de quelques poètes épicuréens à la fin du XVIIe” in Laclos et le libertinage, eds. Pomeau and Versini (Paris: Presses universitaires de France, 1983): 21-46.
  • Perkins analyzes the neo-Epicurean ethics of Deshoulières.

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola College of Maryland
U. S. A.

La Sablière, Marguerite Hessein de (1640—1693)

Madame de la Sablière made distinctive contributions to moral and religious philosophy in 17th century France. Her ethical theory implies that the natural moral virtues are disguised vices and that only the theological virtues can sustain an authentic moral life. Her moral rigorism appears in the severity with which she treats questions of moral agency and responsibility. In her treatment of religious knowledge, she focuses on the spiritual conditions necessary for a proper grasp of the attributes of God. Self-abandonment, marked by detachment from the faculties of imagination and intellect, is the necessary condition for an apophatic (or negative theological) recognition of God’s essence.

Madame de la Sablière has long occupied a modest niche in literary, religious, and scientific history. French literature textbooks cite her as the hostess of a prominent literary salon and as the patron of La Fontaine. French Catholic devotional tracts celebrate her as the model convert, the savante who abandoned the skepticism and sexual license of the salon to become a pious servant of the incurably ill. Several histories of science present her as one of the first woman astronomers, due to her research undertaken at the Observatory of Paris. Only in the late 20th century has La Sablière the philosopher emerged into view.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. Works
3. Philosophical Themes
   1. Critique of Virtue
   2. Theological Virtues
   3. Moral Passions
   4. Religious Epistemology
4. Reception and Relevance
5. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

In 1640 Marguerite Hessein was born into the Huguenot elite of Paris. Like other members of the Protestant high bourgeoisie, Hessein belonged to a family prominent in the field of finance. Her father Gilbert Hessein acquired a substantial fortune through the bank he had founded. Her mother Marguerite Menjot Hessein was the daughter of a high-ranking official in the treasury. The spiritual and social life of the family focused on the Huguenot church at Charenton, a Paris suburb where public Protestant worship was permitted. Marguerite was baptized at the church on March 18, 1640.

After the death of her mother in 1649, Marguerite Hessein’s education was placed under the care of her maternal uncle Antoine Menjot and her cousin Madeleine Gaudon de la Raillière. A medical doctor and Protestant apologist, Menjot devised a sophisticated curriculum to be taught by a series of specialized tutors. The study of the classics was so successful that the pupil would later be renowned for her mastery of both Latin and Greek, an unusual accomplishment for a woman of the period. The rigorous instruction in mathematics initiated her lifelong love for science and her avid participation, also unusual for a woman of the period, in the scientific circles of Paris. Menjot personally instructed his niece in the theological principles of Calvinism and introduced her to philosophy. This early formation in philosophy stressed contemporary philosophy, with particular emphasis on the schools of René Descartes and Pierre Gassendi.

An arranged marriage between Marguerite Hessein and Antonie de Rambouillet de la Sablière was held on March 15, 1654. Like his wife, Monsieur de la Sablière descended from an affluent Huguenot family prominent in finance. In addition to wealth, he brought artistic distinction to the marriage. Fluent in Italian, he had already established himself as a leading poet through the publication of his madrigals. Despite the economic, religious, and cultural affinities of the spouses, the marriage unraveled in its second decade. The infidelities of the husband and the physical and emotional violence he directed toward his wife became increasingly more pronounced. After failed efforts at reconciliation, Madame de la Sablière obtained a legal separation of goods and persons in 1668. Recognizing the wife as the innocent partner in the failed marriage, the court required the delinquent husband to return her dowry to her and to pay her substantial alimony. It was Monsieur de la Sablière, however, who maintained custody of the three children from their marriage.

In 1669 a newly independent Madame de la Sablière started a literary salon in her home on the Rue Neuve-des-Petits-Champs in Paris. The salon quickly established itself as one of the capital’s cultural centers. Prominent writers habituating the salon included Molière, Racine, and Madame de Sévigné. Several salon members were prominent in the philosophical debates of the era: Fontenelle, Huet, and Queen Christina of Sweden. During this period, La Sablière also deepened her knowledge of scientific and philosophical culture. A series of tutors instructed her on the latest scientific developments: Roberval on calculus, Sauveur on geometry, and Barthélemy d’Herbelot on anatomy. She attended the public lectures of D’Alencé on physics, Verney on anatomy, and Cassini on astronomy. Actively involved in the practical experiments at Cassini’s observatory, La Sablière distinguished herself by her astronomical research.

Her principal tutor François Bernier focused on philosophy. An opponent of Descartes, he explained to her the contemporary controversies concerning Cartesian physics and metaphysics. He composed his Summary of the Philosophy of Gassendi for her use and dedicated his Pyrrhonic treatise Doubts to her. The personal philosophical opinions of La Sablière during her career as a salonnière remain uncertain. Although some chroniclers classify her as a salon Cartesian, her old mentor Antoine Menjot describes her mature philosophical position as a synthesis between Pyrrhonic skepticism and Epicureanism.

One salon member quickly became an intimate friend and protégé of La Sablière; Jean de la Fontaine. The celebrated author of Fables, La Fontaine joined La Sablière’s circle in 1670 and became her permanent houseguest in 1673. The impoverished poet frequently praised his benefactress in public. His Discourse for Madame de la Sablière attacked the philosophy of Descartes, in particular the Cartesian mechanistic theory of animal nature. During his inaugural speech as a newly elected member of the Académie française in 1684, La Fontaine praised his patron under the pseudonymn of Iris.

At the end of the 1670s La Sablière underwent a personal crisis. An affair with a military officer, Charles de la Fare, turned sour when the multiple affairs of La Fare become public knowledge in salon gossip. The death of her estranged husband in 1679 left her without the financial resources he had provided through alimony support. Finances forced her in 1680 to abandon her home for a more modest apartment on the Rue Saint-Honoré. The psychological crisis became a spiritual one, culminating in her conversion to Catholicism.

In the early 1680s La Sablière began a new life as a penitent and contemplative. La Sablière devoted herself to meditation and theological study under the spiritual direction of the Jesuit priest Rapin until 1687, and then under the Trappist abbot Rancé until her death. She also began to work as a volunteer at the Hospice des Incurables, a dangerous and unfashionable apostolate since it involved ministry to patients suffering from contagious diseases, including venereal diseases. Devoted to this new life of prayer and charity, La Sablière rented a small apartment on the grounds of the hospital and spent an increasing amount of time in this secluded cell rather than in her official residence. Old salon acquaintances, notably La Fontaine, lamented her reclusiveness and her growing attraction to monastic life.

During these years she maintained an extensive correspondence on theological matters with Rancé and composed the reflections on the moral virtues and passions that constitute her extant philosophical works. The austere life of prayer and service at the Incurables did not end La Sablière’s philosophical and scientific interests. Her well-thumbed personal library, inventoried at the time of her death, contained volumes by Descartes, Malebranche, Marcus Aurelius, Epictetus, and Saint Augustine. Despite the entreaties of her spiritual directors, La Sablière refused to abandon her beloved telescope. Until the last weeks of her life, she continued to observe the movements of the stars and the planets from her apartment and to confide her observations in a notebook.

Madame de la Sablière died on January 6, 1693.

2. Works

The three surviving works of Madame de la Sablière date from the last decade of her life, when she led a contemplative existence as a lay volunteer at the Hospice des Incurables. Christian Maxims is a collection of observations on the moral life, focused on the virtues, the vices, and the passions. A popular literary genre in the salons of the period, the maxime was an epigram that dissected the contradictory currents of the human heart. Sablière transformed the genre by giving it a theological armature. Her maxims repeatedly use Scripture, the sacraments, and church tradition to demonstrate her theses on the illusions of natural moral virtue. A brief spiritual treatise, Christian Thoughts explores the spirituality of total abandonment of the human soul to the will of a hidden God. This collection of spiritual counsels argues that authentic knowledge of God requires the quieting of human intellectual, volitional, and imaginative powers. Her surviving correspondence, addressed primarily to her spiritual director Jean-Armand le Bouthillier de Rancé, abbot of La Trappe, concerns the spiritual difficulties encountered by La Sablière in her effort to renounce the worldliness of her earlier life as a salonnière and to lead an ascetical life of contemplation, penance, and service amid the terminally ill. It also reflects her substantial theological culture as she comments on the works of patristic authors who analyzed the virtue of humility. Saint Gregory the Great, Saint Dorotheus, and Saint Bernard of Clairvaux are the most frequently cited.

The history of the survival of the works of La Sablière indicates how easily the work of women philosophers in the early modern period can be lost and forgotten.

Christian Maxims was first published anonymously in 1705 in an edition of the maxims of La Rochefoucauld. The title was simply Les Maximes Chrétiennes de M*****. A subsequent edition of La Rochefoucauld in 1736 reprinted La Sablière’s work anonymously. Only in 1743 did a new edition of La Rochefoucald attribute the Maximes Chrétiennes to Madame de la Sablière. The attribution cited a 1736 royal permission to publish the work granted to the publisher Étienne Ganeau as the authority for the attribution. A subsequent 1777 edition reaffirmed La Sablière as the rightful author of the work. The close match between the style and concerns of the work to her correspondence with Rancé confirmed the attribution of authorship to La Sablière. The convoluted itinerary of Christian Maxims as an anonymous work, occasionally misconstrued as the work of La Rochefoucauld, demonstrates how anonymous and pseudonymous authorship, often employed by women of aristocratic rank during this period, could lead to the loss of the works by women authors.

La Sablière’s correspondence and Christian Thoughts followed a more tortuous itinerary. In the late nineteenth century Menjot d’Elbenne, the erudite biographer of La Sablière, investigated a manuscript collection of letters housed at the Chateau of Chantilly. Labeled Letters of Madame de Sablé, the letters were addressed to Abbé de Rancé and discussed spiritual concerns related to service at the Hospice des Incurables and to the three adult children of La Sablière. Menjot d’Elbenne immediately recognized that it was La Sablière, not Sablé, who had composed the letters. An ambiguous reference to “M.D.L.S.” as the author of the collection had apparently misled an earlier manuscript editor. Fragmentary transcriptions of La Sablière’s letters by Mademoiselle de la Jonchapt, the secretary to Madame de Maintenon, provided external confirmation of the attribution to La Sablière. Pensées Chrétiennes de D.M.D.L.S., a small spiritual treatise contained in the Chantilly manuscript collection, was also clearly identified as the work of La Sablière due to external and internal evidence.

Only in Menjot d’Elbenne’s critical edition of her writings (1923) were the three extant works of La Sablière finally available to the public. Her skill as a moraliste in Christian Maxims, Christian Thoughts, and in her correspondence with Rancé was now apparent.

3. Philosophical Themes

The philosophical reflection of La Sablière focuses primarily on moral and religious questions. In the field of ethics, she dwells on the question of virtue. She critiques natural moral virtues as masks of vice, in particular as outcroppings of pride. Conversely, she exalts the theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity as the necessary foundation for the conduct of a moral life. Like the moral virtues, the passions are treated with skepticism. It is the will, and not the emotions, that must ground the moral agent in the practice of authentic virtue. In her religious philosophy, she stresses the ascetical and mystical conditions necessary for a proper knowledge of the godhead shrouded in obscurity.

a. Critique of Virtue

In Christian Maxims, La Sablière analyzes the moral life in terms of its characteristics of virtue and vice. On the surface, the moral life is a civil war between the paramount virtue of humility and the cardinal vice of pride. Beneath the surface, however, the moral virtues are often nothing more than disguised expressions of vice. Without the redemptive power of grace, the moral virtues are only frail counterfeits of authentic virtue and incapable of sustaining an ethical life.

On a superficial level, the moral life is a transparent struggle between the opposed forces of virtue and vice. For La Sablière, this struggle is ultimately a conflict between the virtue of humility and the vice of pride. Humility is the central moral virtue for the upright moral agent. “The true glory of a Christian does not consist in elevating oneself above others but in humbling oneself [CM no.59].” Pride is the vice corrupting much of human moral conduct. “Pride is the source of all our commotions and all our disturbances [CM no.75].” External moral conflict is the expression of this often hidden psychological conflict between pride and humility in the soul of the moral agent.

At a deeper level, the moral constitution of vice and virtue is more ambiguous. La Sablière argues that virtue is often scarcely masked vice. Many public displays of rigorous virtuous action are secretly fueled by the vice of pride. “We often lay down severe principles of conduct out of arrogance. We like to decorate ourselves with the appearance of virtue and it costs us nothing to give others an unsupportable yoke we would never give ourselves [CM no.23].” Even apparently humble actions are often vitiated by vice. “The sentiments of humility apparent in our words are insincere if at the same time we are angrily trying to convince others to accept what we say about ourselves [CM no.24].” Like the other virtues, humility in word and action often serves strategies of conquest rooted in self-interest.

La Sablière’s deflation of natural moral virtue does not spare the cardinal virtues. Prudence, a central cardinal virtue in the neo-Aristotelian ethics of the period, is dismissed as a species of self-interested risk management. “Prudence is cowardly and timid if it is not animated by the virtue of charity [CM no.72].” This hallowed virtue is only the disguised vice of cowardice. Similarly, La Sablière contests the humanist esteem of the alleged virtues of the pagan heroes of classical antiquity. Their vaunted courage has nothing to do with authentic virtue. “The virtue of the pagans occasionally induced them to scorn the world but only Christian virtue can make being scorned by the world something desirable [CM no.48].” The pagan contempt of the world, motivated by pride and the desire to manifest one’s superiority, has nothing in common with the saint’s contempt of the world, motivated by the love of God.

The enlightened moral agent should shun the cultivation of the natural moral virtues, given his fragility and proneness to hide substantial destructive vices. “If one recognized that virtues acquired with so much effort can quickly disappear in the commotion of the world, one would not seek his or her happiness in them. On the contrary, one would flee them as an enemy who only thinks about stealing our most precious treasures [CM no.51].” From La Sablière’s perspective, efforts to cultivate the moral virtues independently of the treasures of faith and grace can only produce disguised vices that will provide the moral agent with neither temporal nor eternal happiness. The good pagan, made virtuous through the self-disciplined exercise of freedom, is illusory in a human race ravaged by sin and concupiscence.

b. Theological Virtues

Christian Maxims argues that the possession of theological virtues is necessary for a proper perception of the moral order and for a personal capacity to adhere to the goods of that order. As gifts of God’s grace, these infused habits of the soul free their moral agent to abandon moral illusions (which are fabricated by a darkened intellect) and overcome the inconstancy of a will corrupted by sin. In her exaltation of the theological virtues as the foundations of an authentic moral life, La Sablière focuses on the principal theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity.

Faith gives its believers a veridical vision of the moral order, she says, for it is an assent of the mind to truths revealed by God. It is only through faith, and not through the work of an intellect weakened by sin, that the moral agent can properly perceive the moral order and its demands. “Faith makes us regard as goods what the world regards as evils and as evils what the world regards as goods. And it is from the difference between these ideas that is born the different conduct of the just and of the sinful [CM no.11].” Rather than deepening the moral vision of the human intellect operating in the state of concupiscent weakness, faith initiates a perception of the moral order that contradicts the moral vision of fallen humanity. Rather than complementing it, faith squarely opposes the interpretation of morality proposed by the world in its confusion. Only in the light of faith, can the contours of the authentic moral order appear.

The theological virtue of hope is essential for endurance by the moral agent in the combat to be faithful to the demands of the moral order. Only hope for eternal union with God can sustain the moral agent in a spiritual warfare that contains many opportunities for despair. “If the hopes that we develop for our salvation are not rounded in God’s Word, they are false and misleading. In vain do we promise ourselves what God does not promise [CM no.80].” The hope here is none other than the hope of eternal life with God, rooted in the resurrection of Christ proclaimed by the Scriptures. The earthly hopes of self-improvement or social success are only counterfeits of authentic hope and incapable of sustaining the moral agent in the combat to adhere to the moral order.

The theological virtue of charity enjoys the primacy of the virtues grounding a proper moral life. La Sablière insists that charity is a matter of the will and not of the emotions. “The love that God demands of us is not a sensate love, but a preferential love, which commits us to sacrifice everything rather than displease Him [CM no.11].” The moral life is ultimately theocentric. For the mature moral agent, the deepest motivation for moral conduct is a love and fear of God that issues in sacrificial service.

For La Sablière, the theological virtues do not crown the natural moral virtues already operating in the moral agent. Without the theological virtues, the alleged moral virtues of the unredeemed moral agent are only the expressions of masked vice. Without faith, the perception of the moral order is illusory. Without hope, the moral combat against the world’s allures cannot be maintained. Without charity as the motive of ethical conduct, self-interest inevitably corrupts the will of the moral agent.

c. Moral Passions

Like the moral virtues, the moral passions receive a critical assessment in Christian Maxims. For La Sablière, the emotions accompanying the moral and religious activity of the upright moral agent can easily mislead. It is the posture of the will, and not the vacillating passions accompanying the will, that determines the moral constitution of the agent. The confusion between the order of the will and the order of the passions often permits the moral and religious life to deteriorate into sentimentality.

Passions constitute a major obstacle to the work of moral reformation inspired by grace. Resolutions to pursue moral conduct requiring self-change are easily countered by the emotions of the moral agent. “Generally, we easily embrace the resolution to reform ourselves. We gladly toy with the idea of virtue. But as soon as we might fight some passion, the resolution weakens. We no longer feel capable of executing an intention we had formed without difficulty but that we cannot execute without doing violence to ourselves [CM no.254].” For La Sablière, the passions are simply the enemy of the will, especially in the painful work of moral reformation. Whereas other moralists of the period distinguished between beneficent and malevolent passions, La Sablière condemns the ensemble of emotions as a lethal threat to the moral life. “The desires inspired by the passions are the wishes of the sick. We cannot satisfy them without destroying ourselves and making ourselves miserable [CM no.84.].” La Sablière’s thoroughgoing critique of the passions reflects the voluntarism of her ethical theory. It is the will alone that is central in determining the character of the moral life. It also expresses her radical Augustinian view of concupiscent humanity, however. Even the emotions of the redeemed bear the distortions of sin; reliance on the emotions for moral guidance easily leads to error and moral decline.

In her critique of the passions, La Sablière devotes particular attention to the emotions surrounding the virtue of repentance. Authentic repentance resides in sorrow for past transgressions, restitution for the damage caused by the transgressions, and a firm resolution to avoid committing similar transgressions in the future. Sorrowful feelings that appear penitential, such as remorse and regret, are not necessarily the expression of virtue. “Only the sadness of penance is a reasonable sadness. All the others are marks of weakness or of the corruption of nature [CM no.54].” It is the will’s decisions, not vague feelings of sorrow, that indicate whether the moral agent has truly embraced the path of repentance central to authentic moral reformation.

Only in prayer can the soul successfully resist the empire of the passions. This combative prayer requires a certain amount of solitude. “We must separate ourselves from the world and in a certain way from ourselves in order to hear God in retreat. The tumult of the world and of the passions often prevents us from hearing Him [CM no.76].” For La Sablière, ethics is ultimately a question of ascetical and mystical theology. The resources to sustain a moral life grounded in the theological virtues and undimmed by the sentimentality of the passions can only emerge in a life of disciplined religious meditation. Contemplative attentiveness to God’s spirit is the pathway to the union with God’s will that is the wellspring of authentic moral conduct.

d. Religious Epistemology

The faith-centered struggle to live a moral life free of illusory virtues and distorting passions reaches its culmination in the union of the human will with the divine will. Christian Thoughts [CT] describes the abandonment of the soul to God that seals the efforts of the upright moral agent to conduct a life grounded on the theological virtues. This account of mystical union as a species of psychological abandonment is also an exercise in religious epistemology. The fullest knowledge of God possible for the human person is a negative one: a grasp of God’s essence through the immediate presence of God and not through the path of images or concepts referring to God. This apophatic knowledge of God requires an abolition of the work of the imagination and of the intellect.

The essential spiritual condition for this union with and knowledge of God is complete detachment. Renunciation of the world is psychic as well as moral. “Consider everything created as if it did not exist and as if it had already returned to the nothingness toward which it runs [CT no.6].” Detachment from self is even more demanding than detachment from the world. The memory requires purification. “Forget everything that the memory has retained. Use it only for God and for our state in life [CT no.4].” Similarly, the intellect must be freed from worldly concerns. “Empty our understanding. Use its operations only for God and for the state where he has placed us [CT no.3].” The will should avoid dissipation and should focus its affections on God alone. “We must keep our mind for considering God alone and our heart for loving God alone [CT no.15].” This insistence on a severe asceticism of the human faculties of memory, intellect, and will reflects the radical theocentrism of La Sablière’s ethics. Only a complete absorption within God can permit the moral agent to conduct an authentic moral life. But it also reflects the apophatic cast of La Sablière’s theory of religious knowledge. The quieting of the faculties of memory, intellect, and will is essential for the immediate recognition of God’s being that emerges in mystical union.

Christian Thoughts evokes the union with God that is the ultimate goal of the ascetical and mystical itinerary of the moral agent. The immediate grasp of God abolishes the need for discursive reflection. “Only consider God working in our soul. We should not add any of our own reflections [CT no.10].” Using the rhetoric of the via negativa (or negative way), La Sablière describes this mature knowledge of God as a species of forgetting. “We should hold our state of being lost in God, considering only Him as our only principle [CT no.11].” Repeated references to the void, nothingness, and sense of loss typifying this state of union reinforce the apophatic nature of mature religious knowledge according to Christian Thoughts.

This account of the knowledge of and union with God affected through self-abandonment reflects the austerity of the spirituality defended by La Sablière’s spiritual director Rancé and the longstanding tradition of apophatic mysticism within Catholicism. It also echoes the spirituality of Quietism, the dissident movement in early modern Catholicism that reached its apogee of influence in the 1690s. For the Quietists, authentic union with God required the abandonment of meditation, which they based on imaginative projection and discursive reflection in favor of meditation conceived as simple self-abandonment to the will of God. For La Sablière, the most mature knowledge of God emerges in the immediate recognition of Him by a human will abandoned to Him. It is this mystical union, veiled in obscurity, that points to God more accurately than can discursive reflection on the divine attributes. Like ethics, religious epistemology ultimately flowers in mystical theology.

4. Reception and Relevance

Until recently, the canon of La Sablière has received only cursory philosophical attention. Several facts explain this eclipse of an author celebrated as a savante and as a moraliste during her lifetime. The misattribution of the works of La Sablière during the two centuries following her death primarily contributed to her name becoming obscured. Only the scholarly work of Menjot d’Elbenne in the early twentieth century permitted the reconstitution of the canon of her works. Her presence in intellectual history as the patron of La Fontaine also obscured her own philosophical contributions. Philosophical chronicles occasionally characterized her as a salon Cartesian (though there are few traces of Descartes in her actual writings) and as the protector of the anti-Cartesian La Fontaine, but her own philosophical and theological views disappeared from view. Like other salonnières of the period, La Sablière suffered from the ridicule with which the culture of the salon was treated by leading male authors of the era. In Book X of his influential Satires, the literary critic Boileau mocked La Sablière as an amateurish pedant who possessed only the veneer of literary and scientific culture. Her telescope (compared to inverted drinking glasses) and her Latin phrases (allegedly full of grammatical errors) are dismissed as a caricature of true intellectual distinction. Unsurprisingly, such misogynist stereotypes of the salonnière stamped La Sablière’s work as devoid of philosophical interest.

Recent commentaries on La Sablière’s writings have restored her status as a moraliste. Her contributions to virtue theory and to moral psychology are more evident. The theological framework in which she develops her ethical arguments, however, is still obscured. Part of the contemporary interest in the moral philosophy of La Sablière is her construction of a distinctively theological, indeed mystical, account of the mature moral life. The theological virtues emerge as the source of, and not the complement to, a life of authentic moral virtue. Sacramental practice and personal meditation are the necessary conditions for the creation and maintenance of a human will truly devoted to the moral good. Like certain contemporary Christian ethicists, La Sablière contests the value of a natural-law ethics because the “nature” on which such an ethics is based is a nature corrupted by sin and indentured to the vices of the world. Her neo-Augustinian moral philosophy is a defense of an ethical code explicitly rooted in grace, the theological virtues, and divine illumination.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

• La Sablière, Marguerite Hessein de. Maximes Chrétiennes, Pensées Chrétiennes, and Lettres, in Menjot d’Elbenne, Samuel, vicomte, Madame de la Sablière; Ses Pensées Chrétiennes et ses Lettres à l’Abbé de Rancé (Paris: Plon, 1923).
  • A critical edition of the three extant works of La Sablière.

b. Secondary Sources

• Boileau-Despréaux, Nicolas. Oeuvres complètes, ed. Françoise Escal (Paris: Gallimard, 1966).
  • In Book X of his Satires, Boileau mocks La Sablière as a superficial pedant.
• Conley, John J. The Suspicion of Virtue: Women Philosophers in Neoclassical France (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press: 2002): 75-96.
  • An exposition and critique of La Sablière’s theological ethics.
• Ganim, Russell. “Scientific Verses: Subversion of Cartesian Theory and Practice in the ‘Discours à Madame de la Sablière,’” in Refiguring La Fontaine: Tercentenary Essays, ed. Anne Birberick (Charlottesville, VA: Rookwood, 1996): 101-125.
  • A detailed analysis of the anti-Cartesian theories in La Sablière’s entourage.
• Menjot d’Elbenne, Samuel, vicomte. Madame de la Sablière; Ses Pensées Chrètiennes et ses Lettres à l’Abbé de Rancé (Paris: Plon, 1923).
  • Erudite and definitive biography of La Sablière.
• Ogilvie-Bailey, Marilyn. “La Sablière, Marguerite Hessein de la,” in Women in Science: Antiquity through the Nineteenth Century (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1986): 118-119.
  • Informative sketch of La Sablière’s scientific achievements and reputation.
• Wall, Glenda. “La Sablière, Marguerite Hessein de la,” in An Encyclopedia of Continental Women Philosophers, ed. K. Wilson (New York: Garland, 1991): 2: 1086-1087.
  • Literary sketch of La Sablière’s biography and bibliography.

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola College in Maryland
U. S. A.