Objects of Perception

The objects of perception are the entities we attend to when we perceive the world. Perception lies at the root of all our empirical knowledge. We may have acquired much of what we know about the world through testimony, but originally such knowledge relies on the world having been perceived by others or ourselves using our five senses: sight, hearing, touch, taste, and smell. Perception, then, is of great epistemological importance. Also, a philosopher’s account of perception is intimately related to his or her conception of the mind, so this article focuses on issues in both epistemology and the philosophy of mind. The fundamental question we shall consider concerns the objects of perception: what is it we attend to when we perceive the world? We begin with five different answers to the question, “On what does my attention focus when I look at the yellow coffee cup in front of me?”

Perceptual Realism or Direct Realism is the common sense view that tables, chairs and cups of coffee exist independently of perceivers. In addition to analyzing this theory, the following major theories of these objects are discussed in the article below:  Indirect Realism, Phenomenalism, the Intentional Theory of Perception and Disjunctivism.

Table of Contents

1. Direct Realism
2. Indirect Realism
   1. The Argument from Illusion
   2. Problems for Indirect Realism
      1. Dualism
      2. Adverbialism
      3. The Veil of Perception
3. Phenomenalism
   1. Problems for Phenomenalism
4. The Intentional Theory of Perception
   1. Clarification of the Intentional Theory of Perception
      1. Non-Conceptual Content
      2. . Phenomenology
5. Disjunctive Accounts of Perception
   1. Disjunctivism and Cognitive Externalism
6. References and Further Reading

1. Direct Realism

Perceptual realism is the common sense view that tables, chairs and cups of coffee exist independently of perceivers. Direct realists also claim that it is with such objects that we directly engage. The objects of perception include such familiar items as paper clips, suns and olive oil tins. It is these things themselves that we see, smell, touch, taste and listen to. There are, however, two versions of direct realism: naïve direct realism and scientific direct realism. They differ in the properties they claim the objects of perception possess when they are not being perceived. Naïve realism claims that such objects continue to have all the properties that we usually perceive them to have, properties such as yellowness, warmth, and mass. Scientific realism, however, claims that some of the properties an object is perceived as having are dependent on the perceiver, and that unperceived objects should not be conceived as retaining them. Such a stance has a long history:

By convention sweet and by convention bitter, by convention hot, by convention cold, by convention colour; in reality atoms and void. [Democritus, c. 460-370 BCE, quoted by Sextus Empiricus in Barnes, 1987, pp. 252-253.]

Scientific direct realism is often discussed in terms of Locke’s distinction between primary and secondary qualities. The Primary qualities of an object are those whose existence is independent of the existence of a perceiver. Locke’s inventory of primary qualities included shape, size, position, number, motion-or-rest and solidity, and science claims to be completing this inventory by positing such properties as charge, spin and mass. The secondary qualities of objects, however, are those properties that do depend on the existence of a perceiver. They can either be seen as properties that are not actually possessed by the objects themselves, or, as dispositional properties, properties that objects only have when considered in relation to their perceivers. On the former interpretation, the cup itself is not yellow, but the physical composition of its surface, and the particular way this surface reflects light rays into our eyes, causes in us the experience of seeing yellow. And, on the latter interpretation, for an object to be yellow is for it to be disposed to produce experiences of yellow in perceivers. Locke is usually seen as being committed to this latter type of account:

Such qualities which in truth are nothing in the objects themselves, but powers to produce various sensations in us by their primary qualities. [Locke, 1690, 2.8.10]

The secondary qualities, then, comprise such properties as color, smell and felt texture.

We have seen that for the naïve realist, objects that are not actually being perceived continue to have all the properties we normally perceive them as having. For the scientific realist, however, only some of the properties we perceive continue to be possessed by objects when there are no perceivers around, these being their primary qualities.

The distinction between primary and secondary qualities is controversial in various ways, but that need not concern us here. What we should be clear on, however, is that the key feature of both naïve and scientific direct realism is that we directly attend to objects whose existence is independent of perceivers, objects that are out there in the world. The following section questions this whole approach.

2. Indirect Realism

The indirect realist agrees that the coffee cup exists independently of me. However, through perception I do not directly engage with this cup; there is a perceptual intermediary that comes between it and me. Ordinarily I see myself via an image in a mirror, or a football match via an image on the TV screen. The indirect realist claim is that all perception is mediated in something like this way. When looking at an everyday object it is not that object that we directly see, but rather, a perceptual intermediary. This intermediary has been given various names, depending on the particular version of indirect realism in question, including “sense datum, ” “sensum,” “idea,” “sensibilium,” “percept” and “appearance.” We shall use the term “sense datum” and the plural “sense data.” Sense data are mental objects that possess the properties that we take the objects in the world to have. They are usually considered to have two rather than three dimensions. For the indirect realist, then, the coffee cup on my desk causes in my mind the presence of a two-dimensional yellow sense datum, and it is this object that I directly perceive. Consequently, I only indirectly perceive the coffee cup, that is, I can be said to perceive it in virtue of the awareness I have of the sense data that it has caused in my mind. These latter entities, then, must be perceived with some kind of inner analog of vision. We shall first look at some weak arguments for this stance. After dismissing these we shall turn to the Argument From Illusion. This is a highly influential argument that many see as persuasive. In addition to supporting indirect realism, the other three theories of perception—phenomenalism, intentionalism and disjunctivism can be seen as responses to it.

As well as looking at my coffee cup, I can look out of my window and see the stars in the night sky. However, it is a fact (one that can amaze on first discovery) that the star at which I am currently looking may have ceased to exist. The pinpoint of light that I see has taken years to reach me, and in that time the star may have turned supernova. How can I, then, be directly attending to that star when it is no longer there? What must be happening is that the light rays that originated from that star have caused in me the presence of a perceptual intermediary, an intermediary that is still present in my mind, and thus, an intermediary to which I can still attend.

This argument can be applied not just to far distant objects, but to everything we perceive. Light also takes time to travel from the cup to my eyes. Therefore, I am now perceiving the cup as it was a fraction of a millisecond ago. The steam I see rising from it is actually further from the cup than it now appears to me. So again, it cannot be the steam that I directly see since I am not seeing it in the state that it is now in. It must, therefore, be a perceptual intermediary that I perceive.

This, however, is not a persuasive line of argument. One should reject the assumption that the object of perception has to exist at the moment we become perceptually aware of that object. Perception is a causally mediated process, and causation takes time. Because of this, at the time when perceptual processing is complete, the properties of perceived objects may be distinct from those possessed by the object at the time when their causal engagement with our perceptual apparatus began. As said, in extreme cases the objects of perception may no longer exist at the moment when the causal process of perception is complete. One should, therefore, accept that all the events we perceive are to some extent in the past.

The fact that perception is a complex causal process motivates some to offer another weak argument for the indirect realist position. There are many neurophysiological features and physiological entities such as retinal images that are involved in perception. Some conclude that I do not directly see the cup; I see it via such entities, and the indirect realist should take these to be his perceptual intermediaries. The correct response here is to agree (as one must) that such physiological items are indeed intermediaries in the process of perception. They are, however, intermediaries in a different sense. The indirect realist claims that we perceive his intermediaries — we attend to them — just as we do to our image in the mirror. His intermediaries are perceptually accessible. This, however, is plainly not true of the physiological components of the perceptual process. They are not, therefore, perceptual intermediaries in the correct sense. They are simply part of the causal mechanism that enables us to perceptually engage with objects, both those around us, and those in the far distance. So far, then, we do not have any reason to give up direct realism. Many, however, have seen the following argument as providing such a reason.

a. The Argument from Illusion

Illusions occur when the world is not how we perceive it to be. When a stick is partially submerged in water, it looks bent when in fact it is straight. From most angles plates look oval rather than round. (We still, of course, believe that the plate is circular and that the stick is straight because of what we know about perspective and refraction; but these objects can still look bent and elliptical if we resist interpreting what we see with respect to such knowledge.) As well as being prey to illusions, we can also have hallucinations in which there is nothing actually there to perceive at all. It is both of these phenomena that are seen to drive the following key argument for indirect realism.

I’ll partly submerge a pencil in my glass of water (the one that is next to my yellow coffee cup). The pencil appears bent. There is, then, a bent shape in my visual field. I know, however, that the pencil is not really bent. (Or, if this were a case of hallucination rather than illusion, there would not be a pencil there at all.) The bent shape of which I am aware, therefore, cannot be the real pencil in the world. Perhaps, then, it is a physical object on the surface of my cornea, or one floating inside my eyeball (it is possible to see such objects). Empirical evidence, however, has shown that there are no such objects that correlate with our perceptual experiences. So, if the bent shape is not a physical object, it must be something mental. As we have seen, these mental items have been coined “sense data”, and it must be these that we attend to in cases of illusion and hallucination.

Let us now turn to the veridical case. Cases of veridical perception are qualitatively identical to those of illusion or hallucination, and so there must be something in common between the normal case and these non-veridical ones. (This is a key assumption to which we shall return.) The conclusion we should draw, then, is that the common factor between the veridical and the non-veridical cases of perception is the presence of a sense datum. Therefore, in cases of veridical perception it is also sense data with which we perceptually engage. According to the orthodox interpretation, Locke can be seen as holding such a theory: “The mind…perceives nothing but its own ideas” [Locke, 1690, 4.4.3]. (Ideas, of course, being mental components akin to sense data.) And, this kind of theory has continued to have a distinguished following, its adherents include Bertrand Russell, Alfred J. Ayer and Frank Jackson (the latter, however, has recently abandoned this view).

There are various problems with this argument and we shall look at some of these in the following section. However, whether or not the argument is successful, there is no doubt that it has been highly influential. The theories of perception covered in the rest of this article are in part driven by the argument from illusion. Phenomenalism (section 3) accepts the existence of sense data, but denies that they play the role of perceptual intermediaries between the world and us. There is no world on the other side of our sense data; or, we should conceive of the material world as a construction of our sense data. Intentionalism (section 4) agrees that there is indeed something in common between the veridical and the non-veridical cases. However, this common factor should not be seen as an object, but rather, as intentional content. And finally, disjunctivism (section 5) undercuts the argument from illusion by rejecting the assumption that there must be something in common between the veridical and non-veridical cases. We will discuss these theories below, but first we shall consider the problems with the very idea of sense data, and with the argument from illusion itself.

b. Problems for Indirect Realism

i. Dualism

Many see a problem with respect to the metaphysics of sense data. Sense data are seen as inner objects, objects that among other things are colored. Such entities, however, are incompatible with a materialist view of the mind. When I look at the coffee cup there is not a material candidate for the yellow object at which I am looking. Crudely: there is nothing in the brain that is yellow. Sense data, then, do not seem to be acceptable on a materialist account of the mind, and thus, the yellow object that I am now perceiving must be located not in the material world but in the immaterial mind. Indirect realism is committed to a dualist picture within which there is an ontology of non-physical objects alongside that of the physical. There are, however, two major difficulties with dualism. These difficulties are outlined below.

The first and greatest problem for the dualist concerns explaining the interaction between mind and body. Remember, the indirect realist accepts that there is a world independent of our experience, and, in veridical cases of perception it is this world that somehow causes sense data to be manifest in our minds. How, though, can causal interactions with the world bring about the existence of such non-physical items, and how can such items be involved in causing physical actions, as they appear to be? If I have a desire for caffeine, then my perception of the coffee cup causes me to reach out for that cup. A non-physical sense datum causes the physical movement of my arm. Such causal relations seem to be counter to the laws of physics. The physical view of nature aims to be complete and closed: for every physical event there is a physical cause. Here, though, the cause of my reaching out for the cup is in part non-physical, and thus, the closure of physics is threatened. The only way to maintain both physical closure and the causal efficacy of the mental is to claim that there is overdetermination, i.e. that my reaching for the cup has two causes, one involving sense data, and one involving purely physical phenomena, either of which is in itself sufficient to bring about that action. This line, however, is difficult to accept since according to such an account my perception of the cup is incidental to my action: I would have reached for the cup even if I was not consciously aware that it was there. There are, then, problems in reconciling a non-physical conception of sense data with certain widely held views concerning causation.

A dualistically conceived mind appears to be paradoxical in the same way as fictional ghosts are: ghosts can pass through walls, yet they do not fall through the floor; they can wield axes yet swords pass straight through them. Similarly, the mind is conceived as both distinct from the physical world, and also causally efficacious within it, and it is not clear how the mind can coherently possess both features. Descartes himself admitted that he was stumped by the problem of how to account for the interaction between physical entities and the mental realm:

It does not seem to me that the human mind is capable of conceiving quite distinctly and at the same time both the distinction between mind and body, and their union; because to do so, it is necessary to conceive them as a single thing, and at the same time to conceive them as two things, which is self-contradictory. [Descartes, 1970, 142]

A second problem associated with the non-physical nature of sense data is that concerning their spatial location. Our perception presents objects as lying in spatial relations with respect to each other. According to the indirect realist, the objects of perception are sense data, and thus, our perceptual experience presents one sense datum as being in front of another, and that green one to the left of that red one: “The relative positions of physical objects in physical space must more or less correspond to the relative positions of sense data in our private spaces” [Russell, 1912, p. 15]. But how can this be so? On the Cartesian conception of dualism, the non-physical does not have spatial dimensions, and so how can one component of this realm be seen as in front of another? And, how can such non-physical entities be describable in the spatial way we describe physical bodies? How can a non-physical sense datum be round or square? The non-physical nature of sense data seems to threaten the coherence of an indirect realist description of sensory experience. We can say that we see the round green object as just to the left of the square red one if we are talking about spatially located objects in the world, but not if we are talking about non-physical mental items, items for which the idea of spatial location has no application.

ii. Adverbialism

Some see the argument from illusion as begging the question. It is simply assumed, without argument, that in the non-veridical case I am aware of some thing that has the property that the stick appears to me to have. It is assumed that some object must be bent. One can, however, reject this assumption: I only seem to see a bent pencil; there is nothing there in the world or in my mind that is actually bent. Only if you already countenance such entities as sense data will you take the step from something appears F to you to there is an object that really is F. Such an objection to indirect realism is forwarded by adverbialists. We can illustrate their claim by turning to other everyday linguistic constructions, examples in which such ontological assumptions are not made. “David Beckham has a beautiful free kick” does not imply that he is the possessor of a certain kind of object — a kick — something that he could perhaps give away or sell in the way that he can his beautiful car. Rather, we take this to mean that he takes free kicks beautifully. When one gives a mean-eye, one looks meanly at somebody else; one does not offer them an actual eye of some kind. Similarly, then, when one perceives yellow one is sensing in a yellow manner, or yellowly. Our perception should be described in terms of adverbial modifications of the various verbs characteristic of perception, rather than in terms of objects to which our perceptual acts are directed. As I sip my drink, I see brownly and smell bitterly; I do not attend to brown and bitter objects, the inner analogues of the properties of the cheap coffee below my nose. As Wittgenstein often took great pains to point out, many philosophical problems are simply the result of grammatical confusion, or, as Lowe puts it, “an inconvenient legacy of Indo-European languages” [Lowe, 1995, p. 45]. In describing our perceptual experiences we are not describing the visual and olfactory properties of mental items; but rather, we are talking about the manner in which we experience the external world. Thus, if one can give an account of what it is to experience in a brown and bitter manner, then one can account for perception without relying upon sense data. This, we shall see below, the intentionalist and the disjunctivist attempt to do.

iii. The Veil of Perception

Indirect realism invokes the veil of perception. All we actually perceive is the veil that covers the world, a veil that consists of our sense data. What, then, justifies our belief that there is a world beyond that veil? In drawing the focus of our perception away from the world and onto inner items, we are threatened by wholesale skepticism. Since we can only directly perceive our sense data, all our beliefs about the external world beyond may be false. There may not actually be any coffee cups or olive oil tins in the world, merely sense data in my mind. However, for this to be a strong objection to indirect realism, it would have to be the case that direct realism was in a better position with respect to skepticism, but it is not clear that this is so. The direct realist does not claim that his perceptions are immune to error, simply that when one correctly perceives the world, one does so directly and not via an intermediary. Thus, things may not always be the way that they appear to be, and therefore, there is (arguably) room for the sceptic to question one-by-one the veracity of all our perceptual beliefs.

3. Phenomenalism

Some have embraced the skepticism suggested by indirect realism and accepted the anti-realist position that there is no world independent of the perceiver. Two strategies that take this line are idealism and phenomenalism. Berkeley (1710) is an idealist. For him, physical objects consist in collections of ideas or, what have later come to be called, “sense data.” It is only objects conceived of in this way of which we can have knowledge. Sense data, however, cannot exist if they are not being perceived, and so, ‘physical’ objects conceived of in this way are also dependent on perceivers. For Berkeley, therefore, the universe simply consists in minds and the sense data that they perceive. There is only immaterial substance.

A consequence of such an account would seem to be that when we do not perceive the world it does not exist; there are gaps in the existence of objects. Berkeley, however, attempts to avoid this conclusion by claiming that God “fills the gaps.” God perceives the objects that are not perceived by us, and thus, sustains their existence; an existence, though, that subsists merely in the realm of ideas or sense data.

[A]ll the furniture of the earth….have not any subsistence without a mind…their being is to be perceived or known,….consequently, so long as they are not actually perceived by me or do not exist in my mind or that of any other created spirit, they must either have no existence at all or else subsist in the mind of some external spirit…. it being perfectly unintelligible….to attribute to any single part of them an existence independent of a spirit. [Berkeley, 1710, part 1, para. 6]

Such a position is of course highly problematic, but perhaps surprisingly, some of its idealistic elements were widely adopted in the early twentieth century by a group of philosophers called ‘phenomenalists.’

Idealists conceive of the world in terms of our actual experiences (and, for Berkeley, those of God). Phenomenalists hold a related position: for them, propositions about the physical world should be seen as propositions about our possible experiences. Or, as Mill (1867) claims, material objects are nothing but “permanent possibilities of sensation.” Phenomenalism is classically taken as a conceptual thesis: statements about physical objects have the same meaning as statements describing our sense data.

The meaning of any statement which refers to a material thing may be fully conveyed in statements which refer solely to sense-data or the sensible appearance of things. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 152. Note, however, that this is not Chisholm’s own view]

Phenomenalism, therefore, avoids the problem of gaps in a distinct way. Physical objects can exist unperceived since there is the continued possibility of experience. To say that the paper clip is in my drawer is to say that I would see it on opening that drawer. The world, then, is described in terms of our current sense data, and in terms of conditionals that detail which sense data we would encounter in counterfactual and future situations. We must, however, be careful to note the crucial difference between the realist and anti-realist readings of such conditionals. Realism, be it direct or indirect, has an account of why such a conditional holds: I will have the experience of perceiving a paper clip since there exists independent of my mind a real paper clip in the drawer. Phenomenalists, however, do not ground their conditionals in this way since there is no world independent of our (possible) experiences. To say that the paper clip is in my drawer, is simply to say that the flux of sense data characteristic of the experience of  opening a drawer will be followed by the experience of perceiving the silvery-colored sense data that constitutes a perception of a paper clip. There is no mention here of an independent world; such conditionals are only described in terms of the content of one’s experiences.

To make the phenomenalist claim clear, it is useful to look at the distinction between dispositional and categorical properties. Conditionals can be used to describe dispositional properties such as solubility: that lump of sugar is soluble since it will dissolve if I put it in my cup of coffee. Dispositional properties, however, usually have a categorical grounding. Sugar is soluble because of its chemical structure. The conditionals of the phenomenalist, however, should be taken as describing dispositions that do not have such a grounding. The regularities in our experience that they pick out do not have a categorical basis, unlike the psychological regularities of the realist that are grounded in our engagement with the existent external world. The experiential regularities of the phenomenalist are brute; nothing further can be said about why they hold.

a. Problems for Phenomenalism

For many, the idealistic nature of phenomenalism is unpalatable. A consequence of phenomenalism would seem to be that if there were no minds then there would be no world. This is so since ‘physical’ objects are simply constructs of our (possible) experience. Let us also consider the thoughts of others. I seem to be able to interpret what you are thinking by considering your behavior, by watching your actions and listening to your utterances. Your behavior, however, like the rest of the material world, simply consists of my sense data and the counterfactual relations of these mental items. Thus, phenomenalism invokes a solipsistic picture in which it is my sense data alone that constitute the world. A phenomenalist sitting here reading this article from the screen must claim that the computer monitor simply consists in the possibility of sensations that their own physical body (also a part of the material world) also has this nature, and that the people which can be seen in the street outside are similarly constructs of the phenomenalist’s own sense data. Phenomenalism is a very radical stance to take.

Also, even for those who do not have qualms about adopting such an idealistic and solipsistic stance, there are arguments which suggest that phenomenalism cannot complete the project it sets itself. A key argument against phenomenalism is the argument from perceptual relativity. Chisholm (1948) argues that one cannot provide translations of statements about physical objects in terms of statements about sense data. For a phenomenalist, the statement that there is an old green olive oil tin to my right means that the experience of reaching to the right would, on encountering the jagged rim, be followed by a sharp sensation; and that the sensation of turning my head would be followed by the presence of green sense data in my visual field. However, such fluxes of experience need not occur in this way. With gloves on, I would not feel such a sharp sensation; and, I may be color blind or the lights may be out and thus I may not experience green sense data. The sensations I have depend on various facts about me (the perceiver) and my environment. There are no lawlike conditional statements that describe the relation between sensations considered in isolation from physical aspects of the perceiver and of the world.

To calculate the appearances with complete success, it is necessary to know both the thing perceived and the (subjective and objective) observation conditions, for it is the thing perceived and the observation conditions working jointly which determine what is to appear. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 513]

A phenomenalist cannot account for such observation conditions since he is not permitted to talk of the physical states of the perceiver or those of the environment. He can only talk of sense data and the relations between them. Therefore, according to Chisholm, there are no phenomenalist translations to be had, and thus, phenomenalism fails.

4. The Intentional Theory of Perception

The last two positions at which we shall look deny that sense data are involved in perception. To do this they must find alternative responses to the argument from illusion, and they must provide a story that explains how we are in direct contact with the world.

Intentionalists emphasize parallels between perceptions and beliefs. Beliefs represent the world: I now have a belief about the pencil tin (the one that used to contain olive oil), and this belief represents that particular part of the world as being green. Beliefs, then, possess aboutness or what philosophers of mind call “intentionality.” Intentionality is considered to be an essential feature of the mind, and it describes the property that certain mental states have of representing — or, being about — certain aspects of the world. The aspects of the world that a belief is about can be specified in terms of its intentional content. The intentional content of my current belief is that tin is green. The intentionalist claim is that perceptions are also representational states (intentionalism is sometimes called representationalism). I can, then, believe that that tin is green, and I can also perceive that it is. You are about to perceive that the first word of the next paragraph is “Let.” Your perception is intentional: it is about a word on the screen; and, its content is that the next word is “Let.”

Let us see how the intentionalist reacts to the argument from illusion. The key claim will be that representational states can be in error. I can have false beliefs: I can believe that my cup is full when it is not; and I can have beliefs about non-existent entities: I can believe that the Tooth Fairy visited me last night. Such beliefs are analogous to the non-veridical perceptual cases of illusion and hallucination. In both belief and perception, the world is represented to be a certain way that it is not. And, crucially, the intentionalist has an account of what such veridical and non-veridical cases have in common: their intentional content. My perception has the representational content, there is a bent pencil there, whether or not there really is such a pencil in the world (I might have been duped and an actual bent pencil placed in the glass). In the veridical case this content correctly represents the world; in the non-veridical case it does not. Intentionalists, therefore, agree with sense datum theorists that there is an aspect of perception that is shared by the veridical and the non-veridical cases. This shared component, however, is not the presence of a perceptual object, but rather, that of a certain intentional content. Therefore, both intentionalists and sense datum theorists can be seen as providing representational accounts of perception: intentional content and the sense data of the indirect realist represent the state of the independent external world. Intentionalists, however, have representation without an ontological commitment to mental objects.

Intentionalism is driven by current themes in the philosophy of mind. Many in that field are optimistic about providing a broadly scientific, causal account of representation and intentionality. If one could provide such an account then a naturalistically acceptable theory of perception should be seen to drop out of this research. To explain perception one does not have to posit non-physical sense data; rather, one could simply use one’s naturalistic account of intentional content, since, according to intentionalists, the important features of perception are captured by this notion.

a. Clarification of the Intentional Theory of Perception

i. Non-Conceptual Content

There is a debate concerning the nature of the representational content relevant to perception. We are talking of content, so all are agreed that such content is evaluable as correct or incorrect. The question of whether the world is as it is represented to be is always pertinent. The debate, however, concerns whether all such representational content must be conceptually structured (see McDowell, 1994, lecture 3); or, whether some of the representational content involved in perception is non-conceptual (see Peacocke, 1992, chapter 3). (A concept is a constituent of thought that is apt for being the content of a judgment or a belief.) Two arguments that suggest the existence of non-conceptual content are those concerning the fine-grain of experience and the experience of animals.

It seems implausible that I have a distinct concept for every shade of brown that I perceive in the pair of battered old corduroy trousers that I am now wearing, or concepts corresponding to all the nuances of my neighbor’s distorted music that I am currently hearing through my study wall. Our experience appears to be more finely grained than our conceptual repertoire. If one is an intentionalist, then one could invoke representational content that is not conceptual to account for the richness of one’s experience. Also, many are unwilling to ascribe conceptual capacities to animals (at least if one goes far enough down the phylogenetic ladder). However, those same people are often less restrictive with their ascription of experiential properties. They would like to allow animals to have experiences and perception without a conceptual framework within which to structure them. If one is an intentionalist, then non-conceptual content could also be invoked to account for animal perception.

ii. Phenomenology

There are problems associated with accounting for the phenomenological features of perception. My experience consists in more than simply representing that the world is a certain way; it is also the case that the way I acquire representations strikes my consciousness distinctively. Right now there is a faint sound of a road drill syncopating with the reverse warning beep of a supermarket delivery truck; the yellow cup in front of me is slowly fading to brown as a cloud passes overhead; and the smell of coffee is struggling to get past my persistent cold and the pungency of my throat lozenges. All of this is part of my perceptual experience, and for the intentionalist, this experience consists in such representational content as, the truck is emitting a beep, and, my throat lozenge is pungent. There is also, however, something “it is like” to be having such representations (see Nagel, 1974). Our experience has a phenomenological dimension, a dimension that you are probably currently imagining. The shrill beep goes right though me, and the lozenge is so strong that although it pervades my consciousness, I somehow also feel sharper, clearer, more finely tuned to the quality of the air that I am breathing. The intentionalist, therefore, must also account for these phenomenological properties of perception. I shall look at two responses here, one that develops the intentionalist line in order to account for these features of perception, and one that takes such considerations to show that a pure intentionalist account is untenable.

One route that the intentionalist could take is to identify the phenomenological aspects of our experience with the representational. Naturalistically minded philosophers attempt to provide a causal account that explains how our mental states, experiences and perceptions have the intentional content that they do. One could, then, claim that the causal processes that ground intentional content also have a phenomenological aspect. It is the very same state that has both representational content and phenomenological features.

There are, however, problems associated with such a claim. Some see an unbridgeable gap between physical and phenomenological phenomena (see Levine, 1983). Any account couched in terms of the broadly physical properties of the brain cannot hope to capture the conscious, phenomenological dimension of thought and perception.

[There is] the feeling of an unbridgeable gulf between consciousness and brain process…This idea of a difference in kind is accompanied by slight giddiness. (Wittgenstein, 1953, § 412)

Others, however, see this explanatory gap as illusory (see Tye, 2002). Here, though, is not the place to pursue this debate.

The second broad response to the phenomenology of experience is to claim that representational properties alone cannot account for perception, and thus, one should reject the intentionalist project. If one is to account for what it is like to perceive the world, then one also requires sensational properties (properties distinct from those relevant to representation). Peacocke (1988) supports this line. He suggests examples in which there are aspects of our experience that have the same representational content, yet which differ in their phenomenological character. He therefore claims that representational content alone cannot account for phenomenology. Ahead of you on the motorway are two trucks, one just ahead and one near the horizon. You represent them as being of the same size and as moving at the same speed. There is, however, a sense in which the nearer one seems bigger to you — it takes up more of your visual field — and, it moves across your visual field at a faster rate. These features of your experience, then, are not captured in terms of representational content. Peacocke’s claim, therefore, is that “concepts of sensation are indispensable to the description of the nature of any experience” [Peacocke, 1983, p. 4].

Advocates of Peacocke’s line often favor the existence of qualia (singular: quale). These are seen (by some) as the non-representational, phenomenological properties of experience. One must, however, be very careful when reading the literature concerning qualia since the term is sometimes used in other ways. Others see it as merely referring to the phenomenological aspects of our experience (whether or not these can be captured in representational terms). In this sense, qualia are uncontroversial; they merely commit one to the claim that our experience is conscious. Others, notably Dennett (1991, chapter 12), take qualia to be essentially private, and our knowledge of them to be incorrigible. Conceived thus, he denies that there are such entities.

We have, then, been considering whether the phenomenological aspects of perception can be integrated into an intentionalist account. In summary, one can either identify these phenomenological features with the causal processes that are constitutive of the representational content of perception, or one can take such features to demand that an account of perception must include properties other than those that are representational.

5. Disjunctive Accounts of Perception

Finally we have a rather different approach. Disjunctivism denies the key assumption that there must be something in common between veridical and non-veridical cases of perception, an assumption that is accepted by all the positions above, and an assumption that drives the argument from illusion. For the disjunctivist, these cases certainly seem to be the same, but they are, however, distinct. This is because in veridical perception the world is presented to us. The world is not just represented as being a certain way, as for the intentionalist; but rather, the world partly constitutes one’s perceptual state. Thus, one’s perceptual state when hallucinating is entirely distinct from one’s perceptual state when actually attending to the world. To be in the state that I am in when I veridically perceive a green tin, there really has to be something there that is green. This, remember, is also one of the commitments of the sense datum theorist; but for the disjunctivist, the green item is in the world, it is not an internal mental object.

This position is called “disjunctivism” because when I seem to see a green tin, I am either perceiving a green tin or it is as if there is a green tin in front of me (a disjunction of perceptual states). I am not in a perceptual state that is common to both types of experience.

Of facts to the effect that things seem thus and so to one, we might say, some are cases of things being thus and so within the reach of one’s subjective access to the external world, whereas others are mere appearances. [McDowell, 1986, p. 241]

Disjunctivism can avoid the argument from illusion since it does not accept that veridical and non-veridical perceptual states are in any way the same (they only seem to be). We do not, therefore, have to posit a common factor, either in the form of a sense datum, or an intentional content. There is, then, a key difference between the strategies of the intentionalist and the disjunctivist: intentionalists answer the argument from illusion by claiming that veridical and non-veridical perceptions have a type of representational state in common, whereas disjunctivists undercut the argument by claiming that there is no need to posit such a common factor.

Proponents of disjunctivism see their position as upholding certain common sense assumptions about the nature of perception. It is claimed that both sense datum theorists and intentionalists do not account for the idea that it is the qualities of the tin in front of me of which I am directly conscious. This is because for the former it is the qualities of a mental sense datum that are the focus of my consciousness; and for both, the content of one’s experience could be just the same even if there was not a tin there and one was hallucinating. Such accounts, then, do not capture the intuition that the nature of my current experience is constituted by my consciousness of the properties of the tin at which I am looking.

However, in any particular case the disjunctivist must accept that he cannot tell which disjunct holds. When prey to illusion or hallucination, it can seem to you as if you are really perceiving the actual state of the world, and thus, it seems to you that you are in the same perceptual state that you would be in if the world was really how you perceive it to be. A consequence of disjunctivism, then, is that one can be not only deluded about the state of the world, but also about the state of one’s own mind. When one is unknowingly prey to illusion or hallucination, one is in fact in an entirely distinct perceptual state from the state that one takes oneself to be in. This is an anti-Cartesian position since:

In a fully Cartesian picture, the inner life takes place in an autonomous realm, transparent to the introspective awareness of its subject. [McDowell, 1986, p.236]

[The mind is] a realm of reality in which samenesses and differences are exhaustively determined by how things seem to the subject, and hence which are knowable through and through by exercising one’s capacity to know how things seem to one. [Ibid. P.249]

a. Disjunctivism and Cognitive Externalism

A consequence of disjunctivism is that two physically identical brains can be in distinct perceptual states. Imagine there is a demon or a very clever scientist who uses his supernatural powers or hi-tech wizardry to simultaneously remove the green tin from existence, while stimulating my brain in the way that it would have continued to be stimulated if the green tin had remained there on my desk. If this were so, experientially everything would appear to me to be the same as it is now, and, ex hypothesi, the flux of my brain states would also be the same as that which is currently occurring as I now look at the tin. According to the disjunctivist, however, such demonic intervention will induce in me an entirely distinct perceptual state, that of a hallucinatory rather than a veridical perception. Many cannot accept this consequence of disjunctivism. They claim that the mind must supervene on the brain, i.e. that if the physical states of two brains are identical, then so too must be the thoughts, experiences, and perceptions manifest in those brains.

However, the disjunctivist conclusion can be embraced by those who accept cognitive externalism. For such externalists, the world plays a constitutive role in determining the content of our mental states: “Cognitive space incorporates the relevant portion of the ‘external’ world” [McDowell, 1986, p. 258]. The contents of the brain alone do not determine the nature of our thoughts and experiences. There is, however, some notion of supervenience maintained in that the mind supervenes on the brain together with its causal links to the environment: if there are two identical brains causally connected to the same features of their environment, then the mental states manifest in those brains must also be identical.

Various arguments have been forwarded for this externalist position; most notable is Putnam’s Twin Earth thought experiment (1975). We can imagine two physically identical characters, Oscar and Toscar; Oscar lives here and Toscar lives on Twin Earth, a superficially identical planet over the other side of the universe. Oscar and Toscar are molecule for molecule alike, right down to the structure of their brains; and, they both have beliefs about the clear stuff that lies in puddles and rains from the sky. On Twin Earth, however, this clear refreshing liquid is in fact XYZ and not H₂0. Toscar, then, is thinking about different stuff to Oscar, and therefore, the thoughts of Oscar and Toscar have different content, even though we have specified that everything inside their heads is the same. The externalist stance can be summarized thus: “Thought content ain’t in the head” (to hijack Putnam’s phrase). Disjunctivists hold a parallel claim: since it is the state of the world that determines the content of one’s perceptual state, hallucinations have nothing perceptually in common with veridical perceptions even though all could be the same inside one’s head. Therefore, one must accept such externalist thinking if one is to take on the disjunctivist position.

We have, then, come to the end of our survey and we have found that perception is the focus of rich philosophical debate. We have seen that it is the point at which the philosophy of mind, epistemology and metaphysics meet. Therefore, one’s account of the objects of perception will be characteristic, not only of one’s views on how we acquire knowledge about the world, but also, of one’s philosophical perspective on such wider issues as those concerning the constitution of the mind, the constitution of the world, and crucially, how the former engages with the latter.

6. References and Further Reading

• Barnes, J., Early Greek Philosophy, Penguin, London, 1987.
• Dennett, D., Consciousness Explained, Little, Brown and Company, New York, 1991.
• Descartes, R., Descartes: Philosophical Letters, Trans. / ed. A. Kenny, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1970. Levine, J., “Materialism and Qualia: The Explanatory Gap” in Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 64, pp. 354-361, 1983.
• Locke, J., An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, ed. P. H. Nidditch, 1975, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1690.
• Lowe, E. J., Locke on Human Understanding, Routledge, London, 1995.
• McDowell, J., “Singular Thought and the Extent of Inner Space” in Mind, Knowledge and Reality (1998) Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., pp. 228-259, 1986.
• McDowell, J., Mind and World, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1994.
• Nagel, T., “What it is like to be a Bat” in Philosophical Review, 83, pp. 435-56, 1974.
• Peacocke, C., Sense and Content, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1983.
• Peacocke, C., A Study of Concepts, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1992.
• Putnam, H., “The Meaning of Meaning” in Philosophical Papers, Volume 2, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1975.
• Tye, M., Consciousness, Color, and Content, A Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2002.
• Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical Investigations, tr. G. E. M. Anscombe, Blackwell, Oxford, 1953.

Suggestions for Further Reading

For indirect realism see:

• Ayer, A. J., The Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, MacMillan, London, 1947.
• Russell, B., The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
• Grice, H. P., “The Causal Theory of Perception” in Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
• Jackson, F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1977.

For phenomenalism see:

• Mill, J., An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy, Longmans Green, London, 1867.
• Berkeley, G., A Treatise Concerning the Principles of Human Knowledge, in Berkeley: Philosophical Works, ed. M. R. Ayers (1975) Dent, London, 1710.
• Chisholm, R., “The Problem of Empiricism” in Journal of Philosophy, 45, pp. 512-517, 1948.

For intentionalism see:

• Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, A Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
• Armstrong, D. M., Perception and the Physical World, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1961.

For disjunctivism see:

• Hinton, J. M., Experiences, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1973.
• McDowell, J., ‘Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge’ in Mind, Knowledge and Reality (1998) Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1982.

Author Information

Daniel O’Brien
Email: dan_obi@hotmail.com
The University of Birmingham
U. S. A.

Concepts

Concepts are of central importance to an overall theory of cognition and the mind. Our thoughts, especially those that express or involve propositions, are analyzed and distinguished from one another by appeal to various facts involving concepts and our grasp of them. Similarly, our linguistic utterances that express propositions also express concepts, since concepts are normally thought to be closely related to, or even identified with, the meanings of entities like predicates, adjectives, and the like. Our understanding and interaction with the world also involves concepts and our grasp of them. Our understanding that a given thing is a member of a given category is at least partly in virtue of our grasp of concepts, and so are our acts of categorizing. Such capacities involve our knowledge in an essential way, and thus such philosophical issues regarding our epistemic capacities are tied to issues about concepts and their nature. There may be some features and capacities of the mind that do not involve concepts, but certainly the vast number of them do, and thus the task of identifying the correct general theory of concepts is significant to the philosophy of mind, philosophy of language, cognitive science, and psychology.

After an introduction listing many of the more significant philosophical questions concerning concepts, the article provides a detailed list of goals for an overall or complete theory of concepts, sorted according to tasks related to the metaphysics, analysis, and epistemology of concepts. The article also gives a detailed exposition of the main theories of concepts that have been proposed, along with some of the more important objections that have been raised in criticism of each. An annotated bibliography is at the end.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Tasks for an Overall Theory of Concepts
   1. The Metaphysics of Concepts
   2. Analysis of Concepts
   3. The Epistemology of Concepts
3. Theories of Concepts
   1. The Classical Theory, or Definitionism
   2. Neoclassical Theories
   3. Prototype/Exemplar Theories
   4. Theory-theories
   5. Atomistic Theories
4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

What is a concept? When one utters the sentence “Polaris is a star,” the meaning of that sentence is the proposition that Polaris is a star. Alternatively, one’s utterance of that sentence expresses the proposition that Polaris is a star. But in doing so, one also expresses the concept of being a star, the reason being that the predicate ‘is a star’ expresses that concept. Similarly, my belief that Polaris is a star in some sense involves the proposition that Polaris is a star, and part of the content of that proposition is the concept [star] (where the notation ‘[F]’ in what follows signifies the concept of being (an) F). But what is the concept of being a star? This general question raises a host of other questions. For instance: Is there just one concept of being a star, or do individual agents have their own concepts of being a star that might be distinct from one another? Is a concept a mental particular, such as a particular idea in one’s mind? Or are concepts not mental entities at all? Might the concept of being a star instead be something such as the predicate ‘is a star’? Or perhaps the set of stars themselves? Or is the concept of being a star an abstract entity in some sense? And if so, what sort of abstract entity is it? And what makes the concept of being a star distinct from other concepts?

These are metaphysical questions. But there are epistemological questions about concepts as well. For instance, concepts seem to be the sorts of things that get grasped, possessed, or understood in coming to have beliefs (and ultimately knowledge) about the world. But the nature of concept possession is itself a bit mysterious. Is there just one way to possess a given concept, or might there be many such ways? Does possession of the concept of being a star require some sort of complete understanding of that concept or not? And how does one first come to grasp the concept of being a star? Finally, various sorts of behavior seem to be explained in terms of one’s grasp of concepts. For instance, one can consider Polaris, the sun, Jupiter, and the Andromeda galaxy, and one can categorize those things as being stars or not. Performing such sorting behavior accurately is a prerequisite for various sorts of knowledge, thus categorization is of interest to philosophers working in epistemology, and explaining how such behavior happens is of interest to psychologists. Categorization seems to have something to do with one’s grasp of the concept of being a star, but what is the relationship between that ability, the grasping of that concept, and the nature of that concept in itself?

2. Tasks for an Overall Theory of Concepts

As the preceding questions imply, there are a wide variety of tasks for an overall theory of concepts to accomplish. Various theories of concepts handle some of them, but few claim to handle them all. But what should such an overall theory of concepts provide? The question is a useful one for three reasons: First, answering it will make as clear as possible just what issues about concepts a given view addresses and which it does not. Thus it will be clearer what else must be added to the view in question in order to provide a complete account of concepts. Second, the demands on a theory of concepts are logically related to each other, and such relationships themselves serve to raise problems for various candidate theories of concepts. For instance, a Platonistic view of the metaphysics of concepts takes concepts to be abstract entities that are neither physical nor spatiotemporal. But such a metaphysical commitment as to the nature of concepts has consequences with respect to the right conditions on concept possession. For instance, one sort of objection faced by a Platonist is that Platonism about concepts would render concepts unpossessible. That is, if concepts are nonspatiotemporal, it is difficult to see how beings like ourselves could ever be related to concepts in such a way as to possess or understand them. So identifying at least some of the requirements on an overall theory of concepts makes the task of evaluating a given view of concepts easier. If a view of concepts is such that it would then be impossible to satisfy one or more of the other requirements of an overall theory of concepts, then the view fails. Finally, if there are candidate requirements on an overall theory of concepts that turn out on further inspection not to be requirements of such a theory at all, then no theory of concepts should be faulted for failing to satisfy that requirement.

At least some of the following general requirements have been proposed (and see also Rey 1983/1999 and Prinz 2002, Ch. 1 for similar lists). A complete theory of concepts should provide:

An account of the metaphysics of concepts

• An answer to the problem of universals, treating the problem of what concepts are as a special case
• An account of concepts as universals with concepts distinguished from other sorts of universals
• An account of the identity conditions for concepts
• An account of the distinction between simple and complex concepts

An account of analysis for concepts

• An account of the satisfaction conditions for being in the possible-worlds extension of a given concept
• An account of logical constitution for concepts
• An account of the distinction between primitive and complex concepts
• Specific conditions on correct analyses

An account of the epistemology of concepts

• An account of concept possession
• An account of concept acquisition
• An account of categorization

The following sections are devoted to a more detailed discussion of the requirements themselves.

a. The Metaphysics of Concepts

Metaphysical issues involving concepts include what their status is as universals (and also as distinct from other sorts of universals), whether they are mind-dependent or mind-independent entities, what their identity conditions are, and whether they are metaphysically simple or complex.

First, concepts are universals. Distinct verbal expressions (such as distinct predicates, for instance) may nevertheless express the same concept. For instance, ‘is red’ in English and ‘ist Rot’ in German are distinct predicates that express the same concept. Similarly, ‘is the author of The Firm’ and ‘is The Firm’s author’ seem to express the same concept. Predicates that necessarily refer to all of the same things, such as ‘is an equiangular triangle’ and ‘is an equilateral triangle’, are more controversial examples. So are pairs of expressions related by the analysis relation, such as ‘brother’ and ‘male sibling’. The public character of concepts is further evidence that concepts are universals. That is, concepts can be understood by different agents, so it seems that the very same concept can be represented in many different minds at once, much as pain (a type of mental state) can be had by many different agents at the same time. Even if each agent has a pain that is her own, there is still something that all of those agents share—they all are in pain. Similarly for concepts—there is something we all share in virtue of possessing the concept of being a star, for instance, even if precisely speaking, what is present in each of our minds may not be exactly the same. Finally, concepts typically may have multiple “exemplifications” or “instances” across possible worlds, and this is also evidence that concepts are universals. There are many instances of the concept of being a star, for instance, since there are many stars. Hence the so-called “problem of universals” applies to concepts, and a complete account of concepts must defend some theory of universals with respect to them. (It is noteworthy that some authors, e.g., Prinz 2002, reject the notion that concepts serve as linguistic meanings, focusing instead on other functions that concepts have been invoked to serve. Yet even if concepts are not identical to linguistic meanings of some kind, the publicity and multiple-exemplifiability of concepts serves as evidence that they are universals.)

As with other universals (such as properties, relations, and propositions), the available theories include various versions of realism and nominalism. Realism about concepts is the view that concepts are distinct from their instances, and nominalism is the view that concepts are nothing over and above, or distinct from, their instances. Ante rem realism (or Platonism) about concepts is the view that concepts are ontologically prior to their instances—that is, concepts exist whether they have instances or not. In re realism about concepts is the view that concepts are in some sense “in” their instances, and thus are not ontologically prior to their instances. Conceptualism with respect to concepts holds that concepts are mental entities, being either immanent in the mind itself as a sort of idea, as constituents of complete thoughts, or somehow dependent on the mind for their existence (perhaps by being possessed by an agent or by being possessible by an agent). Conceptualist views also include imagism, the view (dating from Locke and others) that concepts are a sort of mental image. Finally, nominalist views of concepts might identify concepts with classes or sets of particular things (with the concept [star] identified with the set of all stars, or perhaps the set of all possible stars). Linguistic nominalism identifies concepts with the linguistic expressions used to express them (with the concept [star] identified with the predicate ‘is a star’, perhaps). Type linguistic nominalism identifies concepts with types of verbal expressions (with the concept [star] identified with the type of verbal expression exemplified by the predicate ‘is a star’). (Platonists about concepts would of course include Plato himself, and modern Platonists include both Chisholm 1996 and Bealer 1993. Aristotle is the most well-known in re realist, though it is somewhat unclear what his view of concepts, construed as linguistic meanings, would be. Most of the early moderns, including Locke, Berkeley, and Hume, seem to espouse some version of conceptualism, and the views of most contemporary cognitive scientists and psychologists imply a commitment to either conceptualism or some sort of nominalism. Quine 1953, 1960 is one of the more recognizable nominalists about universals, though he is also a skeptic about linguistic meaning generally.)

The different options as to the metaphysical status of concepts can also be sorted out depending on the view’s take on the question of whether concepts are mind-dependent or not. On many views, and in fact according to nearly all views held in psychology and cognitive science, concepts are things that are “in” the mind, or “part of” the mind, or at least are dependent for their existence on the mind in some sense. Other views deny such claims, holding instead that concepts are mind-independent entities. Conceptualist views are examples of the former view, and Platonistic and some nominalistic views are examples of the latter view. The issue of the mind-dependence of concepts carries a great deal of importance with respect to which (if any) of the currently available views of concepts is correct. For instance, if concepts are immanent in the mind as particular mental representations of some category or other, and if those representations can be shown not to be analyzed in terms of necessary and sufficient defining conditions, then the classical view of concepts (or definitionism) is undermined; yet if concepts exist independently of one’s ideas, beliefs, capacities for categorizing objects, and so on, then empirical evidence concerning our categorization behavior, early childhood mental development, etc. is of much less consequence with respect to the question of what concepts themselves are. Such evidence might be of great importance to theorizing about our grasp or understanding of concepts, but not as important to the metaphysics of concepts themselves.

The distinctions above can cut across one another. For instance, one might borrow Fodor’s (1975) idea that there is a “language of thought” whereby thoughts are structured just as sentences are, and follow the very same sorts of grammatical rules that spoken languages do, and treat concepts accordingly. One could take concepts to be “in the mind,” and also as being identical to types of linguistic representations. The resulting view would be an example of type linguistic nominalism that nevertheless treats concepts as in the mind, and thus as essentially mind-dependent.

Still another task for an overall theory of concepts is to distinguish concepts from other sorts of universals, and the most straightforward way of doing this is to provide an account of the identity conditions for concepts. For example, if it turns out that concepts and properties have different identity conditions, then they must be distinct sorts of entities. And providing an account of the identity conditions for concepts is necessary for another reason too. If concepts are taken to be linguistic meanings, then some account must be given for what holds true when two distinct verbal expressions express the same concept, as well as what holds true when two verbal expressions do not express the same concept. An account of the identity conditions for concepts would be of great assistance here. As a final matter of significance with respect to the metaphysics of concepts, it might be wondered whether concepts are themselves simple or complex. Are concepts “unstructured” entities without proper parts, or are they complexes of simpler entities? As with the other metaphysical requirements on an overall theory of concepts, there are a number of options to pursue. The distinction is considered further below.

b. Analysis of Concepts

Concepts also seem to be the targets of analysis. One of the traditional tasks of analytic philosophy is that of providing analyses of concepts, but an important question is that of what an analysis itself is, and whether or not there are such things.

At the very least, an analysis of a concept should specify the conditions satisfied by those things that are instances of that concept—an analysis of [star] should say what makes a star a star. One might call such conditions the metaphysical satisfaction conditions for concepts, where such conditions specify all possible conditions on which the concept being analyzed would apply. Such conditions specify the “possible-worlds extension” of a concept, namely a set of things, ranging across all possible circumstances, to which that concept would apply. (Note that such a set of conditions might differ from what an agent believes the satisfaction conditions of a given concept to be, and both sets of conditions might vary from what an agent might use to sort or categorize things as being instances of that concept or not.) Specification of such metaphysical satisfaction conditions is necessary for providing an account of the identity conditions for concepts. For example, if two predicate expressions differ in their possible-worlds extension, then the concepts expressed by those predicates must be distinct. And in order for two predicate expressions to express the same concept, they must share the same possible-worlds extension. So analyses should provide the metaphysical satisfaction conditions for the concept being analyzed. There may be many ways of accomplishing such a task. For one might provide such conditions in terms of lists of necessary conditions (as the classical theory of concepts does), in terms of lists of “weighted” typical features (as prototype views of concepts seem to do), in terms of lists of individually necessary conditions that are not jointly sufficient (as neoclassical views do), etc.

Another way of putting this general point about analyses is that analyses specify a logical constitution for the concept being analyzed. For instance, a classical analysis accomplishes this in virtue of specifying a number of concepts related by entailment or logical consequence to the concept being analyzed, and that collection of concepts is a logical constitution for the concept being analyzed. To say that concepts are related by entailment is just to say the following: For the concepts expressed by the predicate expressions ‘is an F’ and ‘is a G’, if the sentence “For all x, if x is an F then x is a G” is a necessary truth, then the concept of being an F entails the concept of being a G. The classical view is committed to this sort of relation holding between a concept to be analyzed and individual concepts included in a logical constitution for that concept—for instance, if a correct analysis of [star] includes being a celestial body as a necessary condition, then something’s being a star logically entails that it is a celestial body.

Do other views of concepts share the classical view’s claim that concepts have logical constitutions? Certainly neoclassical views do, for so long as a given neoclassical view holds that concepts have necessary conditions (no matter what they say about sufficient conditions), such a view claims that there are entailment relations between something’s being an instance of a given concept and that thing’s satisfying the necessary conditions for being an instance of that concept. What of prototype views? Such theorists usually speak fairly strongly against concepts having conceptual analyses, but in the classical sense. But such views could hold a different view of analysis, where such a view holds that concepts have logical constitutions, but the logical relationship between the concept being analyzed and the concepts in its constitution is a statistical relation, rather than entailment. Finally, atomistic views of concepts have a thesis with respect to the logical constitution of concepts: Such views claim that there are no such logical relations among concepts at all. But even so, one still faces the task of defending a thesis with respect to whether complex concepts have logical constitutions or not. And if one does claim that concepts have logical constitutions, one must defend a claim as to the nature of those logical relations between complex concepts and the members of their logical constitutions.

If at least some concepts have logical constituents, then there must be some stock of concepts that are such that they have no logical constituents themselves. That is, there must be some stock of concepts that might appear in the analyses of various complex concepts, but have no analyses themselves. One then wonders what sort of character such primitive concepts have. Various empiricist philosophers (such as Locke and Hume, for instance) have held that primitive concepts are derived immediately from sensation, and thus that all complex concepts are such that their full analyses (all the way down to the primitives) are in terms of sense impressions only. Other views might include such a story for some concepts, but add that there are other primitive concepts not derived from sense impressions. For instance, the concepts of justice and goodness may well be analyzable, but not fully in terms of sense impressions. Various other concepts in philosophy and mathematics have been offered as other candidates, such as the concepts of belief, mind, free action, truth, inference, set, function, and number. What primitive concepts such complex concepts might ultimately be analyzable in terms of, if not in terms of sense impressions, remains something of a mystery. Also mysterious is how one might grasp such primitive concepts initially, especially if one seeks to avoid commitments to innate possession of such concepts.

There are thus two different distinctions having to do with conceptual “complexity,” one being a metaphysical distinction and the other being a logical one. For there is a difference between claiming that a given concept has proper parts (or literal constituents) and claiming that a given concept has logical constituents (or that there are other concepts logically related to that concept). For a view taking concepts to be mental particulars, such a view might hold that even primitive concepts (that is, those having no analyses) nevertheless have proper parts. For instance, physicalists about such mental particulars might nevertheless hold that primitive concepts nevertheless have physical parts that are not themselves concepts. Such concepts would be complex in the metaphysical sense, but not in the logical sense. In contrast, other theories of concepts might take all concepts to be metaphysically simple (with no proper parts), while still taking some concepts to have logical constitutions and some not. Views taking concepts to be abstract, Platonistic entities seem to fall into this category. So there are two different distinctions here that need not coincide. For lack of a better term, one might use ‘complex’ in both distinctions: A concept may be complex in the metaphysical sense (as opposed to its being metaphysically simple), and/or it may be complex in the sense that it has logical constituents (as opposed to its being primitive, or its having no logical constituents). A complete theory of concepts would provide clear accounts of both distinctions, along with which concepts fall into which category.

One final issue concerning analysis is that no matter what view of analysis one holds, one must specify what it is for a candidate analysis to be a correct analysis. But what are the truth-conditions for analyses? For instance, the classical theory of concepts holds that correct classical analyses will have no possible counterexamples. Other views of analysis might share this basic idea, but defenders of such other views would need to give some account of the truth-conditions of analyses in order to state their position in a complete way. On a prototype view of concepts, one would deny that concepts have classical-style analyses, but perhaps “analyze” a given complex concept in terms of features likely to be had by instances of that concept instead. A correct analysis of the concept [bird], then, would include features that really are typical of, or likely to be had by, instances of that concept.

c. The Epistemology of Concepts

Various views on the nature of concepts have been invoked in order to answer a host of questions in epistemology, where such questions are epistemic in the sense that they are tied to questions ultimately about knowledge, belief, and justification. For instance, what propositional knowledge one is capable of attaining seems dependent on what concepts one possesses—one cannot know that the sun is a star unless one can have the thought that the sun is a star, and one cannot have that thought unless one possesses the concept [star]. Moreover, one’s abilities to sort things into different categories seem dependent on what concepts one possesses. One cannot reliably sort red things from yellow things, in the sense of doing so on the basis of knowing the difference between them, unless one possesses the concepts [red] and [yellow]. But in order to provide complete and correct accounts of the contents of one’s thoughts, as well as accounting for cognitive abilities relevant to having knowledge, one needs an account of concept possession, or an account of what it is to grasp, understand, or at least have some understanding of a given concept. Furthermore, a complete account of concept possession should have something to say about how concepts are acquired or “learned” for the first time. For if learning new things about the world at least in some cases involves acquiring new concepts, some account of concept acquisition is necessary for giving a proper account of knowledge acquisition as a whole. So what is desirable of a complete theory of concepts is not only an account of what concepts are in themselves but also an account of what it is to possess or understand them. (See Rey 1983; Peacocke 1989a, 1989b, and 1992; and Bealer 1998 for discussion by philosophers about concept possession, and Rosch 1999, Smith and Medin 1981, and Murphy 2002 for discussion by psychologists.)

3. Theories of Concepts

At least five general theories of concepts have been proposed: The classical theory, which takes concepts to be analyzed in terms of necessary and jointly sufficient conditions; neoclassical theories, which hold that concepts have necessary conditions, but denies that all concepts have individually necessary conditions that are jointly sufficient; prototype theories, which take concepts to be accounted for in terms of lists of typical features (instead of metaphysically necessary conditions) or in terms of paradigm cases or exemplars; theory-theories, which take concepts to be entities individuated by the roles they play in internally represented “mental” theories (where such a theory is immanent in the mind and of some category or other); and atomistic theories, which take most concepts to be primitive unanalyzable entities.

It should be stressed that the theories presently available have not been put forth as purporting to be complete theories of concepts, in the sense that none of them aim to answer all of the questions listed earlier under the heading of tasks for an overall theory of concepts. For instance, prototype views seem focused most sharply on epistemic concerns related to concept possession more than the task of answering questions about the metaphysics of concepts or about the analysis of them. Classical views of concepts give an account of conceptual analysis primarily, and do not usually include accounts of concept possession as well, though some theorists sympathetic to the classical view (such as Peacocke 1992) espouse a theory of concept possession too. The material below contains summaries of the basic tenets of each view, along with some of the more significant objections to each. Possible replies to the objections have been omitted on the grounds of keeping the presentation brief, though they may be found in the materials listed in the references at the end of the article.

a. The Classical Theory, or Definitionism

The classical theory of concepts holds that complex concepts have classical analyses, where such an analysis is a proposition that gives a set of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for being in the possible-worlds extension of the concept being analyzed. To put the matter a slightly different way, the classical view holds that concepts have logical constitutions, which are collections of concepts that are related by entailment to the concept being analyzed. For instance, the concept of being unmarried belongs to a logical constitution of the concept of being a bachelor, in part because something’s being a bachelor entails its being unmarried. To speak of a logical constitution rather than the logical constitution seems necessary since there may be many different analyses of the same concept—e.g., correct analyses of [square] are expressed by “A square is a closed four-sided figure, with sides of equal lengths and neighboring sides orthogonal to each other” and “A square is a four-sided regular figure.” A classical analysis is then a proposition that specifies such a logical constitution by specifying individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions. Some would call such a proposition a definition, though one might use a more refined term and call them classical definitions, since there seem to be many sorts of definitions (e.g., partial definitions, ostensive definitions, procedural definitions, etc.).

One discovers such analyses by the method most famously used by Socrates in Platonic dialogues like the Euthyphro, Lysis and Laches, which seek to find the nature of piety, friendship, and courage, respectively. The method is to consider a candidate analysis of a given concept, with the intent of seeking counterexamples to that analysis. If there are such counterexamples, then the candidate analysis is false, and if there are no possible counterexamples to that analysis, then it is correct. For instance, take the following candidate analysis of the concept of being a square: A square is a four-sided figure. This analysis is inadequate (it is too broad), since a rectangle with neighboring sides of different lengths is a four-sided figure, and yet not a square. Such a figure is a counterexample to the candidate analysis under consideration. Counterexamples can also show a candidate analysis to be too narrow. For instance, take the candidate analysis expressed by “A bachelor is an unmarried male under age 70.” Surely there are some octogenarians who are bachelors, and any of them would count as a counterexample to the candidate analysis. It is the seeking of both sorts of counterexamples that characterizes the seeking of classical analyses.

The quest for classical-style analyses is common in the philosophical literature of the past two and a half millennia, and the classical theory of concepts was in fact the dominant view up to the last half of the Twentieth Century. Examples of classical analyses include Aristotle’s account of definitions themselves as “an account [or logos] that signifies the essence (Topics I),” where “the essence” of something is given in terms of essential or necessary features. Other well-known examples of classical analyses include Descartes’ definition of body as that which is extended in both space and time, Locke’s definition of being free with respect to a given action as being such that one performs that action, chooses or wills that action, and that had one chosen not to do that action, then one wouldn’t have done it. Hume’s definition of a miracle as (1) an event caused by God’s will that (2) violates the laws of nature is yet another example from the early modern period. Gottlob Frege, Bertrand Russell, and G. E. Moore seemed to support the classical theory, and the view was taken more or less as a presumption in Twentieth-Century philosophy until the 1970s at least (Ludwig Wittgenstein 1958, being a notable exception). Contemporary defenders of the classical view include Jackson 1994, 1998, Pitt 1999, Peacocke 1992, and Earl 2002.

Objection (1): Plato’s problem. One perspicuous problem with the classical theory, according to its critics, is that few if any classical-style analyses have ever been widely agreed upon to be correct, especially for philosophically interesting concepts like [justice], [knowledge], and [free action]. This is termed Plato’s problem (by Laurence and Margolis 1999) since in many of Plato’s dialogues where Socrates searches for what we would call a conceptual analysis of some important concept (such as in the Lysis [friendship], Laches [courage], Euthyphro [piety], and Theatetus [knowledge]), the inquiry in the dialogue fails (or, more precisely, is presented as failing). One would think, however, that if the classical theory were correct, then at least some philosophically interesting concepts would have been analyzed successfully by now. Yet they have not, and there are hardly any widely agreed-upon classical analyses either, except perhaps in logic and mathematics. Such evidence might suggest that the classical theory is false, especially if other competing theories of concepts generate correct and widely agreed-upon analyses for concepts.

Objection (2): Problems involving typicality effects. Another problem for the classical theory involves a large body of empirical evidence concerning how humans sort objects into various categories. There is substantial evidence (summarized in Smith and Medin 1981, Rey 1983, Laurence and Margolis 1999, Murphy 2002, and Prinz 2002) that agents sort objects differently (in terms of speed of sorting, reliability of sorting, etc.) depending on how typical those objects are by way of being typical instances of the category in question. For instance, robins are sorted more quickly into the bird category than eagles, penguins, or ostriches, and some birds (e.g., ostriches and penguins) are more likely to be categorized incorrectly as not being in the bird category.

Such so-called typicality effects are the basis for a critical worry about the classical theory. For one might think that typicality effects suggest that what agents actually employ in acts of categorization are not lists of necessary and jointly sufficient defining conditions, but something else (perhaps lists of typical, but not defining features, as suggested by prototype theories of concepts, or perhaps some representation of a paradigmatic or most exemplary instance of that concept, as claimed by exemplar theories of concepts). But if what agents use in acts of categorization are not lists of defining features, this seems not in keeping with the classical theory. At the very least, if some other general theory of concepts accounts for typicality effects while at the same time addresses as many of the overall tasks for a theory of concepts to meet, then it would seem that theory ought to be preferred over the classical view. For instance, adherents of prototype/exemplar views of concepts (to be discussed below) take the empirical evidence concerning typicality effects as strong evidence in favor of their view, since such views analyze complex concepts in terms of the typical features that the empirical evidence seems to identify.

Objection (3): A general worry stemming from Quine’s attack on the analytic/synthetic distinction. If Quine’s (1953, 1960) famous critique of the analytic/synthetic distinction is successful, then the result generates apparently insuperable difficulties for the classical theory. For if Quine is right, then either there is no meaningful distinction between analytic and synthetic propositions, or the distinction does no meaningful philosophical work. Yet according to standard versions of the classical theory of concepts, classical analyses are analytic propositions (though see Ackerman 1981, 1986, and 1992 for the opposing view). In fact analyses and partial analyses such as A square is a four-sided regular figure and bachelors are unmarried males are usually considered to be paradigmatic examples of analytic propositions. But if there are no identifiable analytic propositions as such, then there are no identifiable classical analyses as such. Thus, it would seem that the classical theory is bankrupt if Quine is correct, for there would be no robust distinction between the analyses and the non-analyses, and there should be such a distinction if the classical theory is correct.

b. Neoclassical Theories

Another theory of concepts to consider is the neoclassical view (for further discussion, see Laurence and Margolis 1999 and Earl 2002). Neoclassical views all share a thesis common to the classical theory:

(NC) For every complex concept [C], [C] has individually necessary conditions for something to fall into its extension.

Alternatively, all neoclassical views hold the thesis that complex concepts have neoclassical analyses, where those analyses include (at least) a specification of necessary conditions for something to fall into the extension of the concept being analyzed. Neoclassical views differ from each other, and from the classical view, in terms of what further thesis is held with respect to sufficient conditions for something to fall into the extension of a given complex concept. For instance, one sort of neoclassical view might hold (NC) but hold that there are no concepts that have at least one sufficient condition. Another might hold (NC) but hold that at least some concepts have at least one sufficient condition. Furthermore, neoclassical views differ from one another in terms of what sort of sufficient conditions they posit all, some, or no complex concepts to have. For sufficient conditions themselves seem to come in two types: (1) sufficient conditions that have the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions, and (2) sufficient conditions that do not have such form. So there is a wide range of possible neoclassical views, corresponding to whether one holds that all complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition, or that some complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition, or that no complex concepts have at least one sufficient condition. And among these options, the views divide again with respect to what may be held with respect to what sort of sufficient conditions complex concepts have, or may have, or that some have, etc.

But despite this variety of neoclassical views, for expository and critical purposes only two neoclassical views need to be examined closely, and they can be stated as follows:

(NCV1) All complex concepts have individually necessary conditions, but at least one complex concept has no sufficient conditions of either sort.

(NCV2) All complex concepts have individually necessary conditions, but at least one complex concept has only at least one sufficient condition that does not have the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions.

The reason for examining only (NCV1) and (NCV2) is that eliminating them as possible views of concepts should suffice to eliminate all other varieties of neoclassical views, since other neoclassical views would seem to include either (NCV1), (NCV2), or both.

An objection: The problem of reference determination (and see also Laurence and Margolis 1999, 54-55; and Earl 2002, Ch. 5). One objection to consider is that neoclassical analyses fail to specify the extensions of concepts in a way that is adequate from the standpoint of accounting for concept individuation. That is, neoclassical views hold (at least) that some concepts have only neoclassical analyses (and not classical analyses) either in terms of only individually necessary conditions, or in terms of individually necessary conditions together with at least one sufficient condition not in the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions. The consequence is that distinct concepts could nevertheless share the same neoclassical analyses, and thus the neoclassical view is left with no adequate account of concept identity.

Consider the neoclassical views (NCV1) and (NCV2) once more. In order to evaluate these two views, one need only consider test cases for each view. Call those cases type 1 and type 2 cases:

Type 1: Concepts with individually necessary conditions, but with no sufficientconditions of either sort.

Type 2: Concepts with individually necessary conditions, and with no sufficient conditions that take the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions, but with at least one sufficient condition that does not take the form of a conjunction of individually necessary conditions.

Now take the cases in turn. Consider a test case of type 1, and (NCV1) claims that there are at least some concepts of this type. Let this concept be [C]. A neoclassical analysis of [C] solely in terms of necessary conditions will fail to specify the extension of [C] in an adequate way, it seems, for it would be possible for there to be another, distinct concept [D] with the very same neoclassical analysis. So holding that concepts only have analyses in terms of necessary conditions is insufficient for handling concept individuation.

The point is illustrated most perspicuously with two concepts known to be distinct, and yet share some necessary conditions. Take [parallelogram] and [rhombus], and suppose one offers the following neoclassical analyses for them:

A parallelogram is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and (3) with opposing sides parallel to each other.

A rhombus is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and (3) with opposing sides parallel to each other.

These two analyses specify the very same possible-worlds extension; i.e., they specify the very same reference for [parallelogram] and [rhombus]. But with such analyses only in terms of necessary conditions, neither concept’s extension has been adequately specified. For specifying [parallelogram] and [rhombus]’s extensions in this way leaves it open for them to be distinct concepts.

And they are distinct concepts, in this case, since not all parallelograms are rhombuses. So neither neoclassical analysis specifies the extensions of [parallelogram] and [rhombus] adequately, for while they entail that [parallelogram] and [rhombus]’s extensions overlap, they leave open the possibility that the extensions of [parallelogram] and [rhombus] do not coincide. But if their extensions do not coincide, this would entail that they are distinct concepts. So this sort of neoclassical analysis fails to provide an adequate account of reference determination, and thus (NCV1) fails.

Now consider a test case of type 2, and (NCV2) claims that there are at least some concepts of this type. Once more, neoclassical analyses along the lines of (NCV2) will be in terms of (i) some set of individually necessary conditions that are neither individually nor jointly sufficient; and (ii) some individually sufficient condition not having the form of a conjunction of necessary conditions. Such an account still fails to give an adequate account of reference determination.

For take [parallelogram] and [rhombus] again. Something’s being a square is sufficient for its being a parallelogram as well as for its being a rhombus. So include this sufficient condition in some neoclassical analyses for [parallelogram] and [rhombus]:

A parallelogram is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and a square is a parallelogram.

A rhombus is (1) a closed plane figure (2) with four sides, and a square is a rhombus.

Such neoclassical analyses leave it open for [parallelogram] and [rhombus] to be distinct concepts, despite their having the same neoclassical analyses. For while squares are in the possible-worlds extension of [parallelogram], and also in the possible-worlds extension of [rhombus], the extension of [square] fails to match that of either [parallelogram] or [rhombus]. But [parallelogram] and [rhombus] share a common neoclassical analysis along the lines of (NCV2), and thus they would be identical if (NCV2) were correct, thus (NCV2) has failed to distinguish [parallelogram] from [rhombus]. The same predicament arises for any concepts sharing some necessary conditions and at least one sufficient condition. So (NCV2) fails, the critic might conclude.

The common problem claimed to exist with both sorts of neoclassical analysis is that such analyses fail to specify a complete possible-worlds extension for their analysanda (those concepts being analyzed), and the lesson here seems to be that analyses (of any sort) must do this if one is to distinguish concepts by means of their analyses. For an analysis solely in terms of necessary conditions (which are not jointly sufficient) specifies an extension larger than that of the analysandum (the concept doing the analyzing). But while adding a sufficient condition (not in terms of a conjunction of necessary conditions) to the analysis might capture all of the analysandum’s extension, it nevertheless might specify an extension smaller than the analysandum’s extension. And given that concepts not sharing the same possible-worlds extension are distinct, both neoclassical views’ take on analysis leaves the question of accounting for concept individuation unresolved.

c. Prototype/Exemplar Theories

Prototype theories of concepts come in two versions, and both claim to receive strong support from the existence of typicality effects for acts of categorization. One sort of prototype view holds that concepts should be analyzed in terms of a set of typical features of members of that concept’s extension. For a prototype view that analyzes a concept [C] in terms of lists of typical features, then for each typical feature there is merely some probability that x will have that feature given that x lies in the extension of [C]. So on this sort of prototype view (which is sometimes termed the probabilistic or the statistical view of concepts), the relationship between a concept and the concepts used to analyze it is a statistical relation, rather than an entailment relation (as in the classical theory).

The other sort of prototype view analyzes a concept in terms of a particular exemplary instance (or instances) of that concept, and for this reason is sometimes called the exemplar view of concepts. Whether or not some particular is in a given concept’s extension is then accounted for in terms of the degree of resemblance between that particular and the exemplar for that concept. The exemplar for [apple] might be colored a particular shade of red, have a particular rounded shape, have a particular taste, etc., and whether a particular greenish red thing counts as an apple depends on whether it sufficiently resembles the exemplar (or exemplars) for [apple]. (See Smith and Medin 1981, 1999; Fodor 1998; and Murphy 2002 for general discussion of the two prototype theories. Smith and Medin defend the view in their 1981.)

Objection (1): The problem of typicality effects for definitional concepts. A number of objections have been raised against prototype views, but three have been pressed most often by the critics. The first objection to consider is that there are some concepts that seem definitely not to follow the prototype view, yet are still such that typicality effects have been observed for them. A basic thesis of prototype theories seems to be that when typicality effects are present for a given concept, then the proper analysis for that concept will be in terms of lists of weighted features (on a probabilistic view) or in terms of exemplars (on an exemplar view). If it turns out that concepts that do not have prototypical analyses (e.g., if they have classical analyses) nevertheless are such that there are typicality effects for them, then this would be deeply problematic for prototype theories. Now, take [odd number], which is a concept that does indeed have a classical analysis. Armstrong, Gleitman, and Gleitman 1999 put the matter this way:

Are there definitional concepts? Of course. For example, consider the superordinate concept [odd number]. This seems to have a clear definition, a precise description; namely, an integer not divisible by two without remainder. No integer seems to sit on the fence, undecided as to whether it is quite even, or perhaps a bit odd…. But if so, then experimental paradigms that purport to show [bird] is prototypic in structure in virtue of the fact that responses to ‘ostrich’ and ‘robin’ are unequal should fail, on the same reasoning, to yield differential responses to ‘five’ and ‘seven’, as examples of [odd number] (234, notation for concepts adjusted).

So the idea is that if typicality effects for a concept [C] are intended by prototype theorists to show that [C] follows the prototype view, then for concepts that follow the definitional (or classical) view, there should not be any typicality effects for them.

But for [odd number], typicality effects have been observed for that concept: The number 3 has been found to be more “typical” of the odd numbers than 7, and 7 more “typical” than 501 and 447 (Armstrong, Gleitman, and Gleitman 1999, 232). But as far as the extension of [odd number] is concerned, no odd number is “more of” an odd number than any other, since all odd numbers are odd numbers to the same degree. But given the experimental evidence, the prototype view seems to predict that falling into the extension of [odd number] would be a matter of degree. But this prediction is false, and so it cannot be the case that the prototype view is correct for all concepts. What looks even more damaging is that the empirical results for [odd number] cuts the tie that prototype theorists hold to exist between empirical evidence concerning typicality effects and the proper analysis of concepts. That is, if typicality effects do not support a prototype analysis for [odd number], then it is doubtful that typicality effects support prototype analyses for [bird], [fruit], [sport], or any other concept.

Objection (2): The [pet fish] problem. Two other objections to be considered concern concepts with conjunctive logical form (like [pet fish]) and “negative concepts” (like [not a cat]). Fodor (1998, Ch. 5) has pressed the objection in a particularly clear way, and what follows here keeps closely to Fodor’s presentation. Both objections take as a basic premise the principle of compositionality, which can be stated as follows: “[T]he syntax and the content of a complex concept is normally determined by the syntax and the content of its constituents (Fodor 1998, 94).” That is, the content of an expression of a complex concept is normally determined by the logical constituents of that concept. For instance, in the sentence “Goldberg is a pet fish,” the predicate ‘is a pet fish’ expresses the concept of being a pet fish. The principle of compositionality then suggests that if one were to give an analysis of [pet fish], there should be an analysis of [pet fish] in terms of [pet] and [fish]. Similarly, in the sentence “Goldberg is not a cat,” ‘is not a cat’ expresses the concept of being not a cat, and there should be an analysis of [not a cat] in terms of [cat].

Aside from the intuitive appeal of the principle of compositionality, there are two compelling arguments in favor of it: One (paraphrased from Fodor 1998, 94-95) is that compositionality explains why our cognitive capacities are productive with respect to concepts. There are an infinite number of concept-expressing verbal expressions such that we can understand them, yet since the mind is finite the capacity for such understanding must be “finitely representable.” And since the principle of compositionality explains how such an infinite capacity can be had by a finite mind, one should accept the principle.

Another argument is that the principle of compositionality explains how our cognitive capacities are systematic with respect to concepts (and again see Fodor 1998, 97-99). One example should suffice to illustrate the explanatory tie between compositionality and systematicity: Provided that an agent can grasp what is meant by ‘John’ and ‘Mary’, and that she grasps what is expressed by the predicate ‘is loved by John and Mary’, then she can grasp what is expressed by ‘is loved by Mary and John’. The explanation for why the content of the latter expression can be grasped by an agent given that she grasps the content of the former expression is this. The content of both expressions is compositional, and is composed of the same logical constituents. Compositionality thus explains systematicity, and so the principle of compositionality should be accepted.

The so-called [pet fish] problem is this. For a complex concept like [pet fish] (which in this case has conjunctive logical form), its logical constituents include [pet] and [fish]. Given that the principle of compositionality holds, there should be an analysis of [pet fish] in terms of [pet] and [fish]. But consider the prototype theorist’s analysis of [pet], [fish], and [pet fish]. On a probabilistic view, each of these concepts would be analyzed in terms of lists of weighted typical features. But the list of weighted features for [pet fish] would not be the union of the lists of weighted features for [pet] and [fish]. For instance, the feature of being a dog might be weighted quite high in a prototypical analysis for [pet] (since dogs are typical pets), while being a dog would have to be weighted quite low (zero, in fact) in a prototypical analysis for [pet fish]. But these weights would have to be the same, it seems, if the principle of compositionality holds good. The problem is also perspicuous on an exemplar view’s analysis of [pet fish]: The exemplar for [pet] might be a dog, and the exemplar for [fish] might be a salmon. But if the exemplar for [pet fish] is a goldfish, it is hard to see how this kind of analysis for [pet fish] could ever be a decompositional analysis in terms of the exemplars for [pet fish]’s logical constituents. So prototype theories of concepts fail, the critic concludes. (See Fodor 1998, 102-103; Rey 1983, 260; 1985, 301-302; and Laurence and Margolis 1999, 37-43).

Objection (3): The problem of negative concepts. The third objection to prototype theories concerns what is expressed by negative predicates, such as the predicate of the sentence “Goldberg is not a cat.” It appears to be [not a cat], and according to the principle of compositionality this concept should have an analysis in terms of [cat]. But on a prototype view, [not a cat] seems not to have any prototype analysis at all, much less in terms of the prototypical analysis of [cat]. On a probabilistic view, the analysis of [not a cat] would be a list of weighted typical features of those things that are not cats. But it looks like there are no typical features shared by those things that are not cats. On an exemplar view, [not a cat] would be analyzed in terms of the prototypical thing (or type of thing) that is not a cat. But there is no such exemplar, it seems. So not only is it the case that “negative” concepts like [not a cat] have no prototype analyses in terms of their logical constituents, but they simply have no prototype analyses at all. And so prototype theories fail to account for an important class of concepts, and so the critics conclude that prototype theories fail.

d. Theory-theories

Two such views of concepts receive the name theory-theory, so-called due to the emphasis on general theories of a given category in accounting for various concepts of that category. One sort of theory-theory takes concepts to be structured representations analogous to theoretical terms in science, hence as constituents of propositions, and concepts are individuated in virtue of the roles they play in a “mental theory” an agent has with respect to some thing or category of thing. For instance, an agent might have a mental theory about dogs, and the concept she expresses by ‘is a dog’ in “Fido is a dog” is determined by the role(s) that concept plays in her overall theory of dogs. A mental theory in this sense is analogous to a scientific theory, represented in the mind, where such theories are sets of propositions (or representations of them) that are believed by an agent having that mental theory. Such a mental theory is also used to ground an agent’s inferences (such as explanations and predictions) with respect to what that theory happens to be about. The other sort of theory-theory identifies concepts with such internally represented theories themselves, and thus treats concepts as sets of represented propositions. There is obviously a tension here (as pointed out by Laurence and Margolis 1999, 44). One view treats concepts as being on the same ontological and semantic level (as has this article so far), namely as being entities in terms of which whole propositions are analyzed. Yet the other view treats concepts as being on the same ontological and semantic level as propositions (or sets of them). As this latter sort of theory-theory seems to require some means by which to individuate the various propositions that compose a mental theory, and this would require appeal to the very entities that have been called ‘concepts’ throughout this article, the sort of theory more in line with the other theories of concepts is the first sort of theory-theory. (Carey 1985, 1999 defends a version of the theory-theory, as do Murphy and Medin 1999.)

An objection: The problem of stability. The theory-theory’s view of concept individuation that emerges from its theory of meaning (which is holistic) seems to run contrary to the fairly obvious fact that different agents can possess the same concept. For let the content of a concept be determined by its inferential relations to other concepts as specified by a mental theory. Then two concepts [C] and [D] differ if there is any difference in [C] and [D]’s inferential relations to other concepts as specified by the respective mental theories that include [C] and [D]. But if theories determine the content of the concepts included in them, then any difference in theory seems to entail a difference in concept. Now the problem of stability arises: It is difficult to see how on the theory-theory agents holding different theories could ever possess the same concept. The problem also arises for the same individual if her own theory changes over time. In rejecting one theory in favor of another, the concepts “included” in that theory would change as well.

For instance, a person whose theory included the proposition (or a representation of the proposition) that arthritis was a disease of the muscles as well as the joints would presumably possess a different concept than a person who did not think arthritis was a disease of the muscles. For the first agent’s theory specifies an inferential relation between something’s being a case of arthritis and its being a disease of the muscles, while the other agent’s theory does not. So what the agents express by ‘arthritis’ fail to play the same roles in their respective mental theories, and so those two individuals do not possess the same concept: They express distinct concepts with their respective uses of ‘arthritis’.

This would be a minor problem except for the fact that such differences in mental theories would seem to be ubiquitous. If the theory-theory were right, then any difference in beliefs about arthritis entails a difference in mental theory, and thus there would be a difference between what such agents express by ‘arthritis’. Similarly, a child who believes that something looking like a dog but with no bones is nevertheless a dog would possess a distinct concept from a child who does not have such a belief. And in the general case, agents differ quite often in what they believe about members of a given category, and agents change their minds over time as to what they believe about members of a given category.

The difficulty is even worse if the theory-theorist adopts a global holism. For if one holds that all of one’s mental theories are interconnected by means of further inferential connections, then it seems that agents differing in any belief in any respect would thus possess none of the same concepts. This would clearly be counterintuitive, for surely at least some concepts are shared among different agents irrespective of the difference in the totality of their beliefs.

e. Atomistic Theories

The last theory of concepts to consider is conceptual atomism, or what Fodor (1998) calls informational atomism. Atomism differs from the classical, neoclassical, and prototype views in that while those views take concepts to have logical constitutions, atomism denies this. According to atomism, all or most concepts are such that they have no proper analyses in terms of any kind of “constituent” structure construed as a set of either proper-part containment, entailment, or statistical relations, and thus atomism takes all or most concepts to be primitive. Call strong atomism the thesis that all concepts are primitive in this sense, and moderate atomism the thesis that most concepts are primitive, but at least some concepts are complex.

Objection (1): The problem of radical nativism. The objection is an argument for the following claim: If atomism is right, then so-called radical nativism about concepts is true. Depending on what sort of atomism is at issue, then all or nearly all concepts turn out to be innate. Since this is counterintuitive, the critics conclude that there is good reason to reject conceptual atomism.

One note: What is meant by ‘innate’ in this context could mean a number of different things. A concept might be innate if it is “part of one’s nature,” or “hard-wired” into one’s mind from the start. The notion is reminiscent of Descartes’ position that some ideas are innate, such as the idea of God, of infinity, etc. This would indeed make for a counterintuitive result if most or all concepts turned out to be innate in this sense. Intuitively, the possession of [doorknob] (Fodor’s example) is not part of my nature, and nor is it a concept that I have always possessed. Alternatively, a concept might be innate if one has an innate capacity to grasp that particular concept (perhaps given the proper stimuli). It would be counterintuitive if most or all concepts turned out to be innate in this sense as well—[doorknob] seems not to be innate in this sense either. A still more general sense of ‘innate’ seems most adequate here. Take ‘innate’ to mean roughly the same thing as ‘unlearned’ and “unlearned” concepts are those concepts not acquired on any of the models of concept acquisition to be discussed below. And this more general sense of ‘innate’ is consistent with either of the two senses mentioned above: Such a concept could either always be grasped (in the sense of being part of one’s nature) or it could be graspable via some innate faculty tailored for that concept. (See also Fodor 1981 on different senses of ‘innate’ with respect to both innate ideas/concepts and innate cognitive capacities.)

The argument that atomism implies radical nativism runs as follows (from Fodor 1998, Ch. 6). According to conceptual atomism, all (or nearly all, or most) concepts are primitive, in the sense given in section 2b above. That is, atomism holds that all (or nearly all, or most) concepts have no analyses in terms of other, more basic concepts. But primitive concepts are unlearned, or innate, and so conceptual atomism is committed to the thesis that all (or nearly all, or most) concepts are innate. The conclusion is counterintuitive. What of the support for the premise that primitive concepts are innate? Why think that primitive concepts have to be unlearned?

There are two lines of thought to consider, the first given by Fodor (1998, 123-124). Acquiring or learning a concept (or the process of grasping a concept for the first time) is an inductive process, one might think. In acquiring a complex concept, one does so by testing various hypotheses about what properties are shared by all things in the extension of that concept. Succeeding in this process, or arriving at the right hypothesis about what properties are shared by all things falling under a concept, means that one has acquired that concept. However, not all concepts can be acquired in this way, and the concepts not acquired by the inductive model of concept acquisition are the primitive concepts. But we still possess or grasp such primitive concepts even if they are not learned, and so the stock of primitive concepts (however large this stock of primitives is taken to be) are all innate.

The general point seems to be this. If concept acquisition requires some process of hypothesis testing, then acquiring a new concept requires that some concepts already be possessed. For a hypothesis is a proposition, and grasping a proposition indeed seems to require at least some grasp of the concepts expressed in an expression of that proposition. So if hypotheses are tested in acquiring new concepts, and this is the only way to acquire or learn new concepts, then at least some concepts have to be unlearned. So some concepts have to be innate. Since atomists claim that most or all concepts are primitive, the stock of primitives is of course quite large, and thus radical nativism seems to follow.

Laurence and Margolis (1999, 62-63) consider a somewhat different argument for the same conclusion: Complex concepts are initially grasped by “assembling” them from their constituents, and such constituent concepts would have to already be grasped in order for such an assembly procedure to take place. For instance, suppose I grasp [bachelor] for the first time. On the “assembly” model, this occurs in virtue of combining tokens of [unmarried] and [male] by some capacity of conceptual combination, and I could not acquire [bachelor] in this way unless I already had some grasp of [unmarried] and [male]. Yet this sort of process cannot proceed unless there are some concepts not initially grasped by “assembling” them from their constituents. For instance, I might have acquired [male] in virtue of its being assembled from its constituents, and whatever [male]’s constituents are, I acquired them in virtue of their being assembled from their constituents. But this process had to begin with some concepts not initially acquired by this sort of assembly procedure. And these concepts will be the stock of primitives, since primitive concepts have no constituents to “assemble” them from. So if this model of acquiring complex concepts is right, and it is the only way in which concepts in general can be learned, then the consequence seems to be that primitive concepts are innate.

Objection (2): The problem of individuating coextensive and empty concepts. Another objection to atomism claims that since concepts have no structure (according to atomism, that is), atomists seem committed to a view of concept identity that distinguishes concepts from one another solely by their extensions (or possible-worlds extensions). This seems to entail that according to atomism, concepts with the same extension will be identical. But then the concepts [closed triangular figure] and [closed trilateral figure] would be identical, since they share the same possible-worlds extension. Furthermore, according to such an extensionalist view of concept identity, all concepts with no possible-worlds extension at all would be identical, such as [round square] and [round triangle]. However, [triangular closed plane figure] and [trilateral closed plane figure] seem distinct, since being three-angled is distinct from being three-sided, and so do [round square] and [round triangle]. The concepts [water] and [H2O] look to be distinct as well, since “This is a sample of water” and “This is a sample of H2O” seem to have distinct meanings. So the objection is that atomism is committed to a view of concept identity that is incorrect, and so atomism is false. (For Fodor’s replies see his 1998).

4. Conclusion

Research into the nature of concepts is ongoing, in both philosophy and psychology, and there is no general consensus in either field as to the preferred theory of concepts. The theories above primarily address the tasks of answering questions about the analysis of concepts, along with the broadly epistemic questions about them listed at the outset, while not always addressing the metaphysical questions directly. Yet the metaphysical issues do bear on the plausibility of one theory over another. As mentioned earlier, if concepts are abstract Platonistic entities, and not internal mental representations that are “in the head,” then the classical view might escape some of the objections raised by prototype theorists. Alternatively, if concepts are “in the head” as mental representations of some sort, and are structured in terms of the conditions one uses in sorting things as falling under that concept or not, then the classical theory looks bankrupt and the prototype theory looks superior to the rest. Whether the nature of a concept is to have such structure, as opposed to classical structure, a structure more along the lines of the theory-theory, some other structure entirely, or no structure at all, is a thoroughly unresolved matter.

5. References and Further Reading

• Ackerman, D. F. 1981. “The Informativeness of Philosophical Analysis.” In P. French, et al. (Eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy, vol. 6. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 313-320.
  • Ackerman’s articles address the question of the nature of classical analysis, referencing G. E. Moore’s early work on the subject, and also C. H. Langford’s criticisms of Moore.
• Ackerman, D. F. 1986. “Essential Properties and Philosophical Analysis.” In P. French, et al. (Eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy, vol. 11. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 304-313.
• Ackerman, D. F. 1992. “Analysis and Its Paradoxes.” In E. Ullman-Margalit (Ed.), The Scientific Enterprise: The Israel Colloquium Studies in History, Philosophy, and Sociology of Science, vol. 4. Norwell, Massachusetts: Kluwer.
• Armstrong, S. L., Gleitman, L. R., and Gleitman, H. 1999. “What Some Concepts Might Not Be.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 225-259.
  • Reports on typicality effects occurring for concepts with classical analyses, such as [odd number], and argues that the prototype theory is thus flawed.
• Bealer, G. 1982. Quality and Concept. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Bealer, G. 1993. “Universals.” Journal of Philosophy 90 (1), 5-32.
  • A defense of a Platonistic view of universals.
• Bealer, G. 1998. “A Theory of Concepts and Concept Possession.” Philosophical Issues 9, 241-301.
• Carey, Susan. 1985. Conceptual Change in Childhood. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
  • An example of a view of concepts falling under the theory-theory.
• Carey, Susan. 1999. “Knowledge Acquisition: Enrichment or Conceptual Change.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 459-487.
• Chisholm, Roderick. 1996. A Realistic Theory of Categories: An Essay on Ontology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • A defense of Platonism about universals.
• DePaul, Michael and Ramsey, William (Eds.). 1998. Rethinking Intuition: The Psychology of Intuition and Its Role in Philosophical Inquiry. Lanham, Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
• Earl, Dennis. 2002. A Defense of the Classical View of Concepts (Doctoral dissertation, University of Colorado, Boulder, 2002). Dissertation Abstracts International, 63, 06A.
  • As the title suggests, a defense of the classical theory.
• Earl, Dennis. 2006. “Concepts and Properties.” Metaphysica 7(1), 67-85.
  • A defense of the view that concepts and properties are one and the same sort of entity.
• Fodor, Jerry A. 1975. The Language of Thought. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
  • A seminal work by Fodor defending the view that thought has linguistic structure. Also includes discussion of innateness, both for concepts and for cognitive capacities.
• Fodor, Jerry. 1981. “The Present Status of the Innateness Controversy.” In RePresentations: Philosophical Essays on the Foundations of Cognitive Science. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press, 257-316.
  • Distinguishes different senses of innateness, and considers different arguments and issues concerning the issue of innateness.
• Fodor, Jerry. 1998. Concepts: Where Cognitive Science Went Wrong. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Fodor’s defense of conceptual atomism, with discussion and criticism of the other views of concepts as well, especially the prototype theory.
• Fodor, J., Garrett, M. F., Walker, E. C. T., and Parkes, C. H. 1980/1999. “Against Definitions.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 491-512.
  • An influential article defending the thesis that most concepts have no classical-style definitions.
• Greig, Gordon. 1970. “Moore and Analysis.” In A. Ambrose and M. Lazerowitz, G. E. Moore: Essays in Retrospect. London: Humanities Press, 242-268.
  • On G. E. Moore on classical conceptual analysis.
• Harman, Gilbert. 1999. “Doubts About Conceptual Analysis.” In Gilbert Harman, Reasoning, Meaning, and Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 139-143.
  • Contains criticism of classical-style analyses.
• Jackson, Frank. 1994. “Armchair Metaphysics.” In M. Michael and J. O’Leary-Hawthorne (Eds.), Philosophy in Mind. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Jackson, Frank. 1998. From Metaphysics to Ethics: A Defence of Conceptual Analysis. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • A defense of classical conceptual analysis.
• Kamp, H. and Partee, B. 1995. “Prototype Theory and Compositionality.” Cognition 57, 129-191.
• Lakoff, George. 1989. “Some Empirical Results About the Nature of Concepts.” Mind and Language 4 (1, 2), 103-129.
• Langford, C. H. 1968. “The Notion of Analysis in Moore’s Philosophy.” In Schlipp 1968, 321-342.
• Laurence, Stephen and Margolis, Eric. 1999. “Concepts and Cognitive Science.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 3-81.
  • An introduction to the issue of the nature of concepts, with extensive discussion of the available views on concepts, with consideration of both support and criticism of each. The article is the introduction to Margolis and Laurence 1999.
• Margolis, Eric. 1994. “A Reassessment of the Shift from Classical Theories of Concepts to Prototype Theory.” Cognition 51, 73-89.
• Margolis, Eric and Laurence, Stephen (Eds.). 1999. Concepts: Core Readings. M.I.T. Press.
  • An anthology of historical and contemporary articles on concepts, by both philosophers and psychologists, with an expansive and useful introduction by the editors.
• Millar, Alan. 1991. “Concepts, Experience, and Inference.” Mind C (4), 495-505.
  • A review of Peacocke 1992.
• Millar, Alan. 1994. “Possessing Concepts.” Mind 103 (409), 73-81.
• Moore, G. E. 1966. Lectures on Philosophy. Ed. C. Lewy. London: Humanities Press.
  • Section I, entitled “What is Analysis?” concerns the nature of classical conceptual analysis.
• Moore, G. E. 1968. “A Reply to My Critics.” In Schlipp 1968, 660-677.
  • Includes more on Moore’s account of classical analysis.
• Murphy, Gregory. 2002. The Big Book of Concepts. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
  • A monograph on theories of concepts, by one of the more important contemporary psychologists in the field.
• Murphy, Gregory and Medin, Douglas. 1999. “The Role of Theories in Conceptual Coherence.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 425-458.
  • Considers various issues concerning the theory-theory of concepts.
• Peacocke, Christopher. 1989a. “Possession Conditions: A Focal Point for Theories of Concepts.” Mind and Language 4 (1, 2), 51-56.
• Peacocke, Christopher. 1989b. “What Are Concepts?” In Peter French, Theodore Uehling, and Howard Wettstein, (Eds.), Contemporary Perspectives in the Philosophy of Language II. Midwest Studies in Philosophy, Vol. XIV (Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press), 1-28.
• Peacocke, Christopher. 1991. “The Metaphysics of Concepts.” Mind C (4), 525-546.
• Peacocke, Christopher. 1992. A Study of Concepts. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
  • Peacocke’s primary and most detailed work on concepts, with the focus on possession conditions for concepts as the basic issue by way of understanding the nature of concepts.
• Peacocke, Christopher. 2000. “Theories of Concepts: A Wider Task.” European Journal of Philosophy 8 (3), 298-321.
• Pitt, David. 1999. “In Defense of Definitions.” Philosophical Psychology 12 (2), 139-156.
  • A defense of a classical-style view of concepts.
• Plato. 1961a. The Collected Dialogues of Plato. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton, New Jersey: Princeton University Press.
• Plato. 1961b. Euthyphro. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 169-185.
  • An early dialogue where the focus is on analyzing [piety].
• Plato. 1961c. Laches. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 123-144.
  • A dialogue where the participants attempt to analyze [courage].
• Plato. 1961d. Lysis. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 145-168.
  • A dialogue considering various analyses of [friendship].
• Plato. 1961e. Theatetus. Trans. L. Cooper. In Plato 1961a, 845-919.
  • A dialogue on the proper analysis of [knowledge], defending the traditional analysis of knowledge as justified true belief.
• Prinz, Jesse J. 2002. Furnishing the Mind: Concepts and Their Perceptual Basis. Cambridge: M.I.T. Press.
• Putnam, Hilary. 1966. “The Analytic and the Synthetic.” In H. Feigl and G. Maxwell, eds., Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. III. Minneapolis, Minnesota: University of Minnesota Press, 358-397.
  • An influential article attempting to undermine, among other things, the analytic/synthetic distinction, and with it the classical view’s commitment to analyses as analytic truths.
• Putnam, Hilary. 1983. “‘Two Dogmas’ Revisited.” In Hilary Putnam, Realism and Reason: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 87-97.
• Quine, W. V. O. 1953/1999. “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 153-170.
• Quine, W. V. O. 1960. Word and Object. Cambridge: The M.I.T. Press.
• Ramsey, William. 1992. “Prototypes and Conceptual Analysis.” Topoi 11, 59-70.
  • A defense of the prototype view, by way of criticizing the classical theory.
• Rey, Georges. 1983. “Concepts and Stereotypes.” Cognition 15, 237-262.
  • A criticism of Smith and Medin 1981’s defense of the prototype theory, with exposition on general tasks for theories of concepts to accomplish.
• Rey, Georges. 1985. “Concepts and Conceptions: A Reply to Smith, Medin and Rips.” Cognition 19, 297-303.
  • Further criticism of the prototype theory.
• Rey, Georges. 1995. “Concepts.” In Samuel Guttenplan, (Ed.), A Companion to the Philosophy of Mind (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers), 185-193.
  • An encyclopedia entry on concepts.
• Rosch, Eleanor. 1999. “Principles of Categorization.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 189-206.
  • An exposition of Rosch’s famous work from the 1970s illuminating typicality effects for various concepts.
• Schlipp, P. (Ed.). 1968. The Philosophy of G. E. Moore. LaSalle, Illinois: Open Court.
• Sibley, Frank. 1966. “Aesthetic Concepts.” In Cyril Barrett, Ed., Collected Papers on Aesthetics. New York: Barnes and Noble, 61-89.
  • This and the following reference defend a view of aesthetic concepts committed to a neoclassical treatment of them.
• Sibley, Frank. 1973. “Is Art an Open Concept? An Unsettled Question.” In Matthew Lipman (Ed.), Contemporary Aesthetics (Boston: Allyn and Bacon, Inc.), 114-117.
• Smith, Edward E. 1989. “Three Distinctions About Concepts and Categorization.” Mind and Language 4 (1, 2), 57-61.
• Smith, Edward, E. and Medin, Douglas L. 1981. Categories and Concepts. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Contains general discussion of research on theories of concepts up to 1981, with a defense of the prototype theory.
• Smith, Edward, E. 1999. “The Exemplar View.” In Margolis and Laurence 1999, 207-221.
  • Chapter 7 of Smith and Medin 1981.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1958. Philosophical Investigations. 3rd Ed. New York: MacMillan.
  • Sections 65-78 include Wittgenstein’s critique of classical-style definitions.

Author Information

Dennis Earl
Email: dearl@coastal.edu
Coastal Carolina University
U. S. A.

Self-Consciousness

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has mostly focused on the identification and articulation of specific epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, peculiarities which distinguish it from consciousness of things other than oneself. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, this article discusses the nature of those epistemic and semantic peculiarities.

The relevant epistemic peculiarities are mainly those associated with the alleged infallibility and self-intimation of self-consciousness. It has sometimes been thought that our consciousness of ourselves may be, under certain conditions, infallible, in the sense that it cannot go wrong: when we believe that some fact about us obtains, it does. It has also sometimes been thought that some forms of consciousness are self-intimating: if a certain fact about us obtains, we are necessarily going to be conscious that it does. These claims have come under heavy attack in more recent philosophical work, but it remains unclear whether some restricted forms of infallibility and self-intimation survive the attack.

The relevant semantic peculiarities have emerged in recent work in philosophy of language and mind. Two of them stand out: the so-called immunity to error through misidentification of our consciousness of ourselves and the special character of self-regarding (or de se) consciousness that cannot be assimilated to other kinds of consciousness. Some philosophers have argued that these are not genuine features of self-consciousness, while others have argued that, although genuine, they are not peculiar to self-consciousness. Other philosophers have defended the proposition that these features are genuine and peculiar to self-consciousness. We will consider the case for these claims in due course.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions
3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?
4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
   1. Immunities to Error through Misidentification
   2. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts
6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?
7. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Throughout our waking life, we are conscious of a variety of things. We are often conscious of other people, of cars, trees, beetles, and other objects around us. We are conscious of their features: their colors, their shapes, and the sound they make. We are conscious of events involving them: car accidents, tree blooming, and so forth.

Sometimes we are also conscious of ourselves, our features, and the events that take place within us. Thus, we may become conscious, in a certain situation, of the fact that we are nervous or uncomfortable. We may become conscious of a rising anxiety, or of a sudden cheerfulness. Sometimes we are conscious of simpler things: that we are seeing red, or that we are thinking of tomorrow’s errands.

In addition, we sometimes have the sense that we are continuously conscious of ourselves going about our business in the world. Thus William James, who was very influential in the early days of experimental, systematic psychology (in addition to being the brother of novelist Henry James and a gifted writer himself), remarked once that “whatever I may be thinking of, I am always at the same time more or less aware of myself, of my personal existence” (James 1961: 42).

These forms of self-consciousness—consciousness of ourselves and our personal existence, of our character traits and standing features, and of the thoughts that occur to us and the feelings that we experience—are philosophically fascinating, inasmuch as they are at once quite mysterious and closest to home. Our scientific theories of astrophysical objects that are incredibly distant from us in both space and time, or of the smallest particles that make up the sub-atomic layer of reality, are mature, sophisticated, and impressive. By contrast, we barely have anything worth the name “scientific theory” for self-consciousness and its various manifestations, in spite of self-consciousness’ being so much more familiar a phenomenon—indeed the most familiar phenomenon of all.

Here, as elsewhere, the immaturity of our scientific understanding of self-consciousness invites philosophical reflection on the topic, and is anyway partly due precisely to deep philosophical puzzles about the nature of self-consciousness. Many philosophers have thought that self-consciousness exhibits certain peculiarities not to be found in consciousness of things other than ourselves, and indeed possibly not to be found anywhere else in nature.

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has thus mostly focused on the identification and articulation of these peculiarities. More specifically, it has sought some epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, that is, peculiarities as regards how we know, and more generally how we represent, ourselves and our internal lives. (In philosophical jargon, “epistemology” is the theory of knowledge and “semantics” is—more or less—the theory of representation.) This entry will accordingly focus on these peculiarities. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, we will discuss first the nature of the relevant epistemic peculiarities and then (more extensively) the semantic ones.

2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions

Let us start by drawing some distinctions. (The distinctions I will draw are meant as conceptual distinctions. Whether they stand for real differences between the properties putatively picked out by the relevant concepts is a separate matter.) The first important distinction is between self-consciousness as a property of whole individuals and self-consciousness as a property of particular mental states. Thus, when we say “My thought that p is self-conscious” and “I am self-conscious,” the property we ascribe is in all likelihood different. My being self-conscious involves my being conscious of my self. But my thought’s being self-conscious does not involve my thought’s being conscious of its self, since (i) it does not have a self, and (ii) thoughts are not the kind of thing that can be conscious of anything. We may call the property that I have creature self-consciousness and the property that my thought has state self-consciousness.

Another distinction is between consciousness of oneself (one’s self) and consciousness of a particular event or state that occurs within oneself. Compare “I am self-conscious of myself thinking that p” to “I am self-conscious of my thought that p.” The latter involves awareness of a particular thought of mine, but need not involve awareness of self or selfhood. It is a form of self-consciousness in the sense that it is directed inward, and takes as its object an internal state of mine. But it is not a form of self-consciousness in the stronger sense of involving consciousness of self. I will refer to the stronger variety as strong self-consciousness and the weaker as weak self-consciousness. State self-consciousness is consciousness of what happens within oneself, whereas creature self-consciousness is consciousness of oneself proper. (Note, however, that a mental state may be both creature- and state-self-conscious. Thus, if I am conscious of my thought that p as my thought, as a thought of mine, then I am conscious both of my thought and of myself.)

Another traditional distinction, which dates back to Kant, is between consciousness of oneself qua object and consciousness of oneself qua subject. Suppose I am conscious of Budapest (or of Budapest and its odors). I am the subject of the thought, its object is Budapest. But suppose now that I am conscious of myself (or of myself and my feelings). Now I am both the subject and the object of the thought. But although the subject and the object of the thought happen to be the same thing, there is still a conceptual distinction to be made between myself in my capacity as object of thought and myself in my capacity as subject of thought. That is to say, even though there is one entity here, there are two separate concepts for this entity, the self-as-subject concept and the self-as-object concept. To mark this difference, William James (1890) introduced a technical distinction between the I and the me. In its technical use, “I” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-subject, whereas “me” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-object. By “Mentalese correlate,” I mean the expression that would mean the same as “I” and “me” in something like the so-called language of thought (Fodor 1975) or Mentalese.)

Corresponding to these two concepts, or conceptions, of self, there would presumably be two distinct modes of presentation under which a person may be conscious of herself. She may be conscious of herself under the “I” description or under the “me” description. Thus, my state of self-consciousness may employ either the “I” mode of presentation or the “me” mode of presentation. (We could capture the difference, using James’ technical terminology, by distinguishing “I am self-conscious that I think that p” and “I am self-conscious that methinks that p.”) In the latter case, there is a sort of “conceptual distance” between the thing that does the thinking and the thing being thought about. Although I am thinking of myself, I am not thinking of myself as the thing that does the thinking. By contrast, in the former case, I am thinking of myself precisely as the thing that is therewith doing the thinking.

Through Kant’s influence on Husserl, philosophers in the phenomenological tradition have long held that something like consciousness of self-as-subject is a distinct, irreducible, and central aspect of our mental life. Philosophers in the analytic tradition have been more suspicious of it (for exceptions to this rule, see for instance Van Gulick 1988 and Strawson 1997). But the distinction between consciousness of self-as-subject and consciousness of self-as-object might be captured using analytic tools, through a distinction between transitive and intransitive self-consciousness (Kriegel 2003, 2004a). Compare “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” and “I am self-consciously thinking that p.” In the former, transitive form, self-consciousness is construed as a relation between me and my thinking. In the latter, intransitive form, it is construed as a modification of my thinking. That is, in the latter the self-consciousness term (if you will) does not denote a state of standing in a relation to my thought (or my thinking) that p. Rather, it designates the way I am having my thought (or doing my thinking). In transitive self-consciousness, the thought and the state of self-consciousness are treated as two numerically distinct mental states. By contrast, in intransitive self-consciousness, there is no numerical distinction between the thought and the state of self-consciousness: the thought is the state of self-consciousness. The adverb “self-consciously” denotes a way I am having my thought that p. No extra act of self-consciousness takes place after the thought that p occurs. Rather, self-consciously is how the thought that p occurs.

I have been speaking of the self-as-subject in terms of “the thing that does the thinking,” and correspondingly of consciousness of oneself as subject in terms of consciousness of oneself as the thing that does the thinking. But recent work in philosophical psychopathology counsels caution here. Schizophrenics suffering from “thought insertion” and “alien voices” delusions report that they are not in control of their thoughts. Indeed, they often envisage a particular individual who, they claim, is doing the thinking for them, or implants thoughts in their mind. Note that although they do not experience themselves as doing the thinking, they do experience the thinking as happening, in some sense, in them. To account for the experiential difference between doing the thinking and merely hosting the thinking, between authorship of one’s thoughts and mere ownership of them (respectively), some philosophers have drawn a distinction between consciousness of oneself as agent and consciousness of oneself as subject (Campbell 1999, Graham and Stephens 2000). The distinction between self-as-agent and self-as-subject is orthogonal, however, to the distinction between self-as-object and self-as-subject. To avoid confusion, let us suggest a different terminology, that of self-as-author versus self-as-owner, and correspondingly, of consciousness of oneself as author of one’s thoughts and consciousness of oneself as owner of one’s thoughts. To be sure, in the normal go of things, ownership and authorship are inseparable. But the pathological cases show that there is daylight between the two notions.

Another important distinction is between propositional self-consciousness and non-propositional self-consciousness. There is no doubt that there is such a thing as propositional self-consciousness: consciousness that some self-related proposition obtains. Presumably, such self-consciousness has conceptual content. But a strong case can be made that there is a form of self-consciousness that is sub-propositional, as it were, and has non-conceptual content (Bermúdez 1998). When a report of self-consciousness uses a “that” clause, as we just did, it necessarily denotes propositional self-consciousness. But when it does not, as is the case, for instance, with “I am self-conscious of thinking that p,” it is left open whether it is propositional or non-propositional self-consciousness that is denoted. That is, “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” is compatible with, but does not entail, “I am self-conscious that I am thinking that p.” In any case, the terminology leaves it open whether there is a non-propositional or non-conceptual form of self-consciousness.

Other distinctions can certainly be drawn. I have restricted myself to those that will play a role in the discussion to follow. They are five:

(a) State self-consciousness versus creature self-consciousness
(b) Strong versus weak self-consciousness
(c) Transitive versus intransitive self-consciousness
(d) Consciousness of self-as-object versus consciousness of self-as-subject
(e) Consciousness of self-as-author versus consciousness of self-as-owner

As I warned at the opening, these distinctions are meant as conceptual ones. This is doubly significant. First, the fact that there is a distinction between two concepts does not entail that there is a difference between the putative properties picked out by these concepts. Second, the existence of a concept does not entail the existence of the property putatively picked out by that concept. In fact, philosophers have questioned the very existence of self-consciousness.

3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?

Perhaps the best known philosophical threat to the very possibility of self-consciousness hails from Hume’s remarks in the Treatise of Human Nature (I, IV, vi): “For my part, when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other… I never can catch myself without a perception, and never can observe anything but the perception.”

This passage makes two separate claims, of different degrees of skepticism. The modest claim is:

(MC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” oneself without a particular mental state.

MC rules out the possibility of a mental state whose sole object is the self. But though it disallows catching oneself without a perception, it does not disallow catching oneself with a perception. Hume makes the latter, stronger, immodest claim next, however:

(IC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” anything but particular mental states.

IC rules out the possibility of any consciousness of one’s self. That is, it rules out the possibility of creature self-consciousness, allowing only for state self-consciousness.

In assessing Hume’s claims, particularly the immodest one, we must ask, first, what did Hume expect to catch? And second, what sort of catching did he have in mind?

One way to deny the possibility of consciousness of oneself is to reject the existence of a self of which one might be conscious. But the inexistence of a self is not a sufficient condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness: there could still be thoroughly and systematically illusory experience of selfhood that gives rise to a form of (illusory) self-consciousness. Nor is such rejection a necessary condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness. Hume himself not only countenanced the self, he offered a theory of it, namely, the bundle theory. What Hume rejected was the existence of a substantival self, a self that is more than just a stream of consciousness and a sum of experiences. What he rejected is the reifying conception of the self according to which the self is an object among others in the world, a substrate that supports the internal goings-on unfolding therein but is distinct from, and somehow stands above, these proceedings. This rejection is shared today by several philosophers (see, for example, Dennett 1991).

This suggests an answer to our first question, concerning what Hume had expected to catch upon turning into himself. What he expected to catch is a self-substance (if you please). It is unclear, however, why Hume thought that consciousness of oneself, even non-illusory consciousness of oneself, required the existence of a substantival self. Consider how self-consciousness might play out within the framework of Hume’s own bundle theory. Upon turning into herself, a person might become conscious of a particular mental state, say an inexplicable cheerfulness, but become conscious of it as belonging to a larger bundle of mental states, perhaps a bundle that has a certain internal cohesion to it at and across time. In that case, we would be well justified to conceive of this person as conscious of her self.

As for the second question, concerning what sort of “catching” Hume had in mind, it appears that Hume envisioned a quasi-perceptual form of catching. He expected self-consciousness to involve some sort of direct encounter with the self. There is no question that one can believe (or otherwise think purely intellectually) that one is inexplicably cheerful. One can surely entertain purely intellectually the proposition “I am inexplicably cheerful.” But Hume wanted more than that. He wanted to be confronted with his self, by turning inward his mind’s eye, as he would with a chair upon directing his outward gaze in the right direction.

In other words, Hume was working with an introspective model of self-consciousness, according to which self-consciousness involves the employment of an inner sense: an internal mechanism whose operation is analogous in essential respects to the operation of the external senses. This inner sense conception was clearly articulated in Locke: “The other fountain [of] ideas, is the perception of the operations of our own minds within us… And though it be not sense, as having nothing to do with external objects; yet it is very like it, and might properly enough be called internal sense” (Essay Concerning Human Understanding II, i, 4).

The plausibility of the introspective model is very much in contention. Thus, Rosenthal (1986) claims that for self-consciousness to be genuinely analogous with perceptual consciousness, the former would have to exhibit the sort of qualitative character the latter does; but since it does not, it is essentially non-perceptual. On this basis, Rosenthal (2004) proceeds to develop an account of self-consciousness in terms of purely intellectual thoughts about oneself (more specifically, thoughts that are entertained in the presence of their object or referent).

On the other hand, self-consciousness can sometimes have a quality of immediacy about it (and its way of putting us in contact with its objects) that seems to parallel perceptual consciousness. At the same time, philosophers have sometimes charged that self-consciousness is in fact too immediate, indeed unmediated, to be thought of as quasi-perceptual. Thus, Shoemaker (1996) argues that the quasi-perceptual model falters in construing self-consciousness along the lines of the act-object analysis that befits perceptual consciousness. When one is perceptually conscious of a butterfly’s meandering, a distinction is always called for between the act of perceptual consciousness and the meandering butterfly it takes as an object. But when one is conscious of one’s cheerfulness, a parallel distinction between the act of self-consciousness and one’s cheerfulness, supposedly thereby taken as object, is misleading, according to Shoemaker.

One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim here is that while Hume’s argument may be effective against transitive self-consciousness, it is not against intransitive self-consciousness. Recall that transitive self-consciousness requires a duality of mental states, the state of self-consciousness and the state of (for example) cheerfulness. But in intransitive self-consciousness there is no such duality: there is not a distinction between an act of self-consciousness and a separate object taken by it. On this interpretation, Shoemaker’s claim is that being self-conscious of being cheerful may well be impossible, but it is nonetheless possible to be self-consciously cheerful. We might combine Rosenthal’s and Shoemaker’s perspectives and suggest the view that self-consciousness can come in two varieties: intellectual transitive self-consciousness and intransitive self-consciousness. Both varieties escape the clutches of Hume’s threat: one can catch oneself (with a particular mental state) if the catching is intellectual rather than quasi-perceptual, or if the catching is somehow fused into the particular mental state thereby caught. What Hume showed is that quasi-perceptual transitive self-consciousness is impossible; but this leaves untouched the possibility of intellectual transitive self-consciousness and of intransitive self-consciousness.

In summary, it is quite likely that self-consciousness is indeed possible. But reflecting on the conditions of its possibility puts non-trivial constraints on our conception of self-consciousness. In this respect, contending with Hume’s challenge still proves immensely fruitful. If anything, it wakes us from our dogmatic slumber about self-consciousness and brings up the question of the nature of self-consciousness.

One question regarding the nature of self-consciousness that arises immediately is what is to count as having self-consciousness. Many contemporary cognitive scientists have operationalized the notion of self-consciousness in terms of experiments on mirror self-recognition and the so-called “mark test.” In these experiments, a creature’s forehead is marked with a visible stain. When placed in front of a mirror, some creatures try to wipe off the stain, which suggests that they recognize themselves in the mirror, while others do not (see mainly Gallup 1970, 1977). Successes with the mark test are few and far between. Among primates, it is passed with any consistency only by humans, chimpanzees, and orangutans, but not by gorillas or gibbons (Suarez and Gallup 1981); and even humans do not typically pass it before the age of a year and a half (Amsterdam 1972) and chimpanzees not before three years of age nor after sixteen years of age (Povinelli et al. 1993). Outside the group of primates, it is passed only by bottlenose dolphins (Reiss and Marino 2001) and Asian elephants (Plotnik et al. 2006). However, this operational treatment of self-consciousness is problematic at a number of levels. Most importantly, it is not entirely clear what the true relationship between mirror self-recognition and self-consciousness is. One would need a principled account of the latter in order to clarify that matter. Mirror self-recognition experiments thus cannot take precedence over the search for an independent understanding of self-consciousness.

To that end, let us consider the ways in which self-consciousness has been claimed to be different, special, and sometimes privileged, relative to consciousness of things other than oneself. Early modern philosophers, from Descartes on, have often claimed certain epistemic privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. More recently, twentieth century analytic philosophers have attempted to identify certain semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness. We take those up in turns.

4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

In what follows, we will consider, somewhat hastily, about a dozen epistemic peculiarities sometimes attributed to self-consciousness. Traditionally, the most discussed special feature claimed on behalf of self-consciousness is infallibility. According to the doctrine of infallibility, one’s consciousness of oneself is always veridical and accurate. We may say that whenever I am self-conscious of thinking that p, I am indeed thinking that p. It is important to note, however, that to the extent that “self-conscious of” is a success verb, this claim would be trivially true, whereas the point of the doctrine under consideration is that it is true even if “self-conscious of” is not a success verb (or also for any non-success uses of the verb). To bypass this technicality, let us insert parenthetically the qualifier “seemingly” into our formulation of the claim. We may formulate the doctrine of infallibility as follows:

(DIF) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I believe something about myself and my mental life, the belief is true: things are in fact the way I believe them to be.

The doctrine of infallibility ensures that my beliefs about my mental life are true. A parallel doctrine ensures that such beliefs are (epistemically) justified. We may, without too much injustice to traditional terminology, call this the doctrine of incorrigibility. The traditional notion of incorrigibility is the notion that the subject cannot possibly be corrected by anyone else, which suggests that the subject is in possession of (and makes correct use of) all the relevant evidence. We may thus formulate the doctrine of incorrigibility as follows:

(DIC) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am justifiably (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p.

Whereas according to DIF, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is true, according to DIC, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is justified.

Against the background of the tripartite analysis of knowledge, the conjunction of DIC and DIF would entail a doctrine about self-knowledge in general, namely:

(DIK) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious that I am thinking that p, then I know that I am thinking that p.

That is, if I am in a state of self-consciousness whose content is “I am thinking that p”, then my state of self-consciousness will necessarily qualify as knowledge. Note, however, that the thesis is entailed by DIF and DIC only against the background of the tripartite analysis—though it may be independently true. (If the tripartite analysis is incorrect, as it probably is, then the thesis does not follow from the conjunction of DIC and DIF. But it can still be formulated.)

The three doctrines we have considered claim strong privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. But there are stronger ones. Consider the converse of the doctrine of infallibility. DIF ensures that when I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am in fact thinking that p. Its converse is a stronger thesis: whenever I think that p, I am self-conscious of doing so. That is, nothing can pass through the mind without the mind taking notice of it. Having a thought entails being self-conscious of having it. Thoughts are, in this sense, self-intimating. We may formulate the doctrine of self-intimation as follows:

(DSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I think something, I inevitably come to believe (or be aware) that I am. Note that DSI entails DIF, because if I am indeed thinking that p, then my self-consciousness of thinking that p must be true or veridical.

A distinction is sometimes made between weak self-intimation and strong self-intimation (Shoemaker 1996). What we have just considered is the weak variety. The strong variety ensures not only that when I think something, I am aware that I think it, but also that when I do not think something, I am aware that I do not think it. Let us formulate the doctrine of strong self-intimation as follows:

(DSSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I am not thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Strong self-intimation renders the mind in some traditional sense transparent to itself. But the term “transparency” has had such wide currency in recent philosophy of mind that it would be better not to use it in the present context.

Consider now the converse of the doctrine of incorrigibility. It is the thesis that if I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p. It also entails DIF, as well as DSI. Again, a strong version can be formulated: If I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I do not think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Finally, a parallel thesis could be formulated regarding knowledge: If I think that p, then I know that I think that p. The strong version would be:

(OSC) If I think that p, then I know that I think that p, and if I do not think that p, then I know that I do not think that p.

This last feature is probably the strongest epistemic privilege that could be claimed on behalf of self-consciousness. We may call the associated doctrine the Omniscience of Self-Consciousness. For it is the thesis that one knows everything that happens within one’s mind, and everything that does not.

Freud’s work on the unconscious has all but refuted the above doctrines (see especially Freud 1915). Thus few if any philosophers would defend them today. But many may consider restricted versions of them. The above doctrines are formulated in terms of thoughts, understood as mental states in general. But some theses can be formulated that would restrict the epistemic privileges to a special subset of mental states, such as sensations and feelings, or phenomenally conscious states, or some such. A thus restricted self-intimation thesis might read: if I have a sensation S, then I am self-conscious of having S; or, if I have a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am self-conscious of having S.

Counter-examples to even such appropriately restricted theses have been offered in the literature. Staying with self-intimation, it has been suggested that there are sensations and conscious states that occur without their subject’s awareness. Arguably, I may have a sensation—indeed, a phenomenally conscious sensation—of the refrigerator’s hum without becoming self-conscious of it, let alone of myself hearing it.

Consider now a restricted version of the infallibility doctrine: If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having sensation S, then I do have sensation S. An alleged counter-example is the fraternity initiation story. Suppose that, blindfolded, I am told that a particular spot on my neck is about to be cut with a razor (this is part of my fraternity initiation); then an ice cube is placed on that spot. At the very first instant, I am likely to be under the impression that I am having a pain sensation, while in reality I am having a coldness sensation. That is, at that instant, I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having a pain sensation but do not in fact have a pain sensation, or so the argument goes (see Horgan and Kriegel 2007).

Another way to restrict the above doctrines is by making their claims weaker. Consider the following variation on self-intimation: If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking. Whereas DSI claims that when I have the thought that p, I am self-conscious not just of having a thought, but of having specifically the thought that p, this variation claims only that I am self-conscious of having a thought—some thought.

We can apply strictures of this type to any of the above doctrines, and some of the resulting theses may be quite plausible. Thus, consider the following thesis:

If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of being in a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am in some phenomenally conscious state.

It is difficult to conceive of a situation in which one is aware of oneself as being in some conscious state when in fact one is in no conscious state (and hence is unconscious). In particular, the fraternity initiation tale does not tell against this thesis: although in the story I am not in fact in a pain state, I am nonetheless in some conscious state.

Such nuanced theses may thus survive modern critiques of the traditional doctrines of epistemic privilege. Their exploration in the literature is, in any case, far from complete. But let us move on to the semantic privileges sometimes imputed on self-consciousness.

5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

a. Immunities to Error through Misidentification

On the two extremes, the first-person pronoun “I” has been claimed by some to be entirely non-referential (Anscombe 1975) and by others to be the only true form of reference (Chisholm 1976 Ch. 3, and in a more nuanced way, Lewis 1979). Presumably, analogous statements could be made about the concept we use in thought in order to think about ourselves in the first person. For convenience, I will call the relevant concept the Mentalese first-person pronoun, or just the Mentalese “I”. Plausibly, the special features of linguistic self-reference (the way “I” refers) derive from, or at least parallel, corresponding features of self-consciousness, and more specifically mental self-reference (the way the Mentalese “I” refers). In the present context, it is the latter that interest us. Our discussion will focus on two main features. In the next section, we will consider the alleged essential indexicality of self-consciousness (Perry 1979) and irreducibility of de se thoughts (Castañeda 1966, 1967, 1968, 1969). (These terms will be explicated in due course.) The present section considers a semantic peculiarity pointed out by Sydney Shoemaker (1968) under the name “immunity to error through misidentification relative to the first-person pronoun” and related peculiarities discussed by Anscombe (1975), Evans (1982), and others.

When I think about things other than myself, there are two ways in which my thoughts may turn out to be false. Suppose I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person. I may be wrong about either (i) whether he is a nice person or (ii) who my next-door neighbor is. The first error is one of mispredication, if you will, whereas the second is one of misidentification. Thus, if I mistake my neighbor’s tendency to smile for kindness, when in fact it serves a cynical ploy to lure me into signing an unjust petition against the superintendent, then I make a mistake of the first kind. By contrast, if I mistake the mailman for my next-door neighbor, and think that it is my next-door neighbor who is a nice person, when in fact it is the mailman who is, then I make a mistake of the second kind.

In this sense, my thought that my next-door neighbor is a nice person displays a composite structure, involving identification and predication. We may represent this by saying that my thought has the internal structure “my next-door neighbor is the person smiling at me every morning & the person smiling at me every morning is a nice person”, or more generally “my next-door neighbor is the φ & the φ is a nice person”. This is not to say that when I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person I am thinking this as a conjunction, or that my thought takes a conjunctive proposition as its object. The above conjunctive representation of my thought is meant just as a device to bring out the fact that my thought has a composite structure. The point is just that my thought has two separable components, an identificational component and a predicational component.

Correspondingly, we can envisage three sorts of semantic peculiarity or privilege. (1) There could be a kind of thought K1, such that if a thought T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to mispredication; thoughts of kind K1 are thus immune to error through misidentification. (2) There could be a kind of thought K2, such that if T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to misidentification; thoughts of kind K2 are thus immune to error through mispredication. (3) There could be a kind of thought K3, such that if T is of that kind, then T can be false due to neither mispredication nor misidentification; thoughts of kind K3 are thus immune to error tout court. The above are just definitions of privileges. It remains to be seen whether any of these definitions is actually satisfied. Shoemaker’s claim is that the first definition is indeed satisfied by a certain subset of thoughts about oneself.

Note that the third peculiarity, immunity to error tout court, is basically infallibility. This way of conceiving of immunity to error through misidentification brings out its relation to the more traditional doctrine of infallibility. Unlike the latter, the doctrine of immunity to error through misidentification does not claim blanket immunity. But it does restrict in a principled manner the ways in which the relevant thoughts may turn out to be false. If I think that I feel angry, then I can be wrong about whether that is a feeling I really have, but I cannot be wrong about whom it is that is allegedly angry.

We said that according to Shoemaker, a certain subset of thoughts about oneself is immune to error through misidentification. What subset? One can think about oneself under any number of descriptions. And some descriptions one may not be aware of as applying to one. Thus, I may think that my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew is brown-eyed, without being aware that I am my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew. In that case, I think about myself, but not as myself. We might say that I have a thought about myself, but not a self-aware thought about myself. Let us call self-aware thoughts about oneself I-thoughts. According to Shoemaker, some I-thoughts are immune to error through misidentification, namely, those I-thoughts that are directed to one’s mind and mental life, as opposed to one’s body and corporeal life. (To take an example from Wittgenstein, suppose I see in the mirror a tangle of arms and I mistakenly take the nicest one to be mine. I may think to myself “I have a nice arm.” In that case, I may not only be wrong about whether my arm is nice, but also about whom it is that has a nice arm. Such an I-thought, being about my body, is not immune to error through misidentification. But my thoughts about my mind are so immune, claims Shoemaker.) More accurately, as we will see later on, Shoemaker holds that absolute, as opposed to circumstantial, immunity to error through misidentification applies only to mental I-thoughts.

We should distinguish two versions of the doctrine of immunity. According to the first, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because the identifications they involve are always and necessarily correct; call this the infallible identification (II) version of the doctrine of immunity. According to the second version, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because they do not involve identification in the first place; call this the identificationless reference (IR) version of the doctrine of immunity. (Brook [2001] speaks of ascriptionless reference, which may also be a good label for the specific feature under consideration.) Both versions claim a certain distinction on behalf of the relevant I-thoughts, but the distinction is very different. The first version claims the distinction of infallible identification, whereas the second one claims the distinction of dispensable identification.

Shoemaker appears to hold the IR version (see, for example, Shoemaker 1968: 558). In some respects this is the more radical version. On the II version, I-thoughts have the same composite structure as other thoughts. When I think that I am amused, the content of my thought has the structure “I am the φ & the φ is amused”. It is just that there is something special about the identificational component in the relevant I-thoughts that makes it impervious to error. Whenever I think that I am the φ, I am. The IR version is more radical. It claims that the relevant I-thoughts do not have the same composite structure as other thoughts—that they are structurally different. More specifically, they lack any identificational component. My thought that I am amused hooks onto me in some direct, identification-free way.

The distinction between these two versions is important, because the burden of argument is very different in each case. To make the case for II, one would have to argue that the relevant self-identifications are infallible. To make the case for IR, by contrast, one would have to argue that the relevant I-thoughts are identification-free. There is also a corresponding difference in explanatory burden. II must explain how is it that certain acts of identification are impervious to error, whereas IR must explain how is it that some acts of reference can dispense with identification altogether (How do they hook onto the right referent without identifying it?).

Shoemaker’s (1968) argument for IR, in its barest outlines, proceeds as follows. Suppose (for reductio) that every self-reference required self-identification. Then every thought with a content “I am F” would have the internal structure “I am the φ & the φ is F”. That is, ascertaining that one is F would require that one identify oneself as the φ and then establish that the φ is F. But this would entail that the same would apply to “I am the φ”: it would have to have the internal structure “I am the ψ & the ψ is the φ”. That is, in order to ascertain that one is the φ, one would have to first identify oneself as the ψ and then establish that the ψ is the φ. And so on ad infinitum. To avert infinite regress, at least some self-reference must be identification-free.

To claim that immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is to claim that it is a feature peculiar to self-consciousness. One can deny this claim in two ways: (i) by arguing that it is not a feature of self-consciousness, and (ii) by arguing that it is not peculiar to self-consciousness (that is, although it is a feature of self-consciousness, it is also a feature of other forms of consciousness).

Several philosophers have pursued (i). Perhaps the most widely discussed argument is the following, due to Gareth Evans (1982: 108). On the basis of seeing in a mirror a large number of hands, one of which is touching a piece of cloth, and a certain feeling I have in my hand, as of touching a piece of cloth, I come to think that I am feeling a piece of cloth. But this is false, and false due to misidentification: I am not the one who is feeling the piece of cloth. Therefore, there are states of self-consciousness that are not immune to error through misidentification; so such immunity is not a feature of self-consciousness as such.

Arguably, however, this is not a pure case of self-consciousness. The thought in question involves self-consciousness, but it is also partly consciousness of something external, and it is the latter part of it that leads to the error. Consider the difference between the thought “I am feeling a piece of cloth” and the thought “I am having a feeling as of a piece of cloth,” or even more perspicuously, “I am having a cloth-ish feeling.” It is clear that if it turns out to be erroneous that I am having a cloth-ish feeling, it is not because I have misidentified myself in the mirror. Indeed, what I see in the mirror is entirely irrelevant to the truth of my thought that I am having a cloth-ish feeling.

More often, philosophers have pursued (ii), arguing that immunity to error through misidentification is not peculiar to self-consciousness. Evans (1982) himself, for instance, argued that thoughts about one’s body, and even certain perceptions and perception-based judgments, can be equally immune to error through misidentification, indeed be identification-free. When I think that my legs are crossed, my thought seems to be immune to error through misidentification: it cannot turn out that someone’s legs are indeed crossed, but not mine.

One response would be to claim that thoughts about one’s own body are a genuine form of self-consciousness, albeit bodily self-consciousness. But another would be to draw finer distinctions between kinds of immunity and attach a specific sort of immunity to self-consciousness. Shoemaker (1968) distinguished between absolute and circumstantial immunity to error through misidentification, claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the absolute variety. In the same vein, McGinn (1983) distinguishes between derivative and non-derivative immunity to error through misidentification, and Pryor (1999) between de re misidentification and which-object misidentification, both claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the latter. However, Stanley (1998) erects a considerable challenge to all these attempts. The issue of whether some kind of immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is still very much debated.

Let us end this section with a few general points. First, immunity to error through misidentification is at bottom a semantic, not an epistemic, peculiarity. It concerns the special way the Mentalese “I” hooks onto its referent. Thus, immunity to error through misidentification is not to be confused with immunity to error through unjustified identification, immunity to unjustifiedness through misidentification, or immunity to unjustifiedness through unjustified identification—all of which would be epistemic peculiarities.

Second, immunity to error through misidentification is a semantic peculiarity of strong self-consciousness, not weak self-consciousness, since it involves essentially consciousness of oneself, not just consciousness of a particular thought of one. So, if I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, it may be that I am not thinking that p, but only because it is not thinking that p that I am doing—not because it is not I who is doing the thinking.

Third, Shoemaker’s “discovery” of immunity preceded the Kripkean revolution in philosophy of language and more generally the theory of reference. A question therefore arises concerning the relation between his claim that self-reference is identification-free and Kripke’s claim that many kinds of reference are direct or rigid. Direct reference—which is commonly thought to characterize proper names, natural kind terms, and indexicals—is reference that is sense-free, if you will: it does not employ a sense, or mode of presentation, in hooking onto the referent. What is the relation, then, between sense-free reference and identification-free reference?

A natural thought is that some (perhaps all) senses are identifications, and so identification-freedom is simply one special case of sense-freedom. If so, Shoemaker’s “discovery” may be just a foreshadowing of the Kripkean revolution: it is the discovery of the possibility of sense-free reference, but with an overly restrictive assessment of its scope (where Kripke claimed that all sorts of representational devices are sense-free, Shoemaker thought that only “I” is).

But there is also another view of the matter. Kripke’s directly referential terms do not employ senses, but they do employ reference-fixers. When I think that Tom is generous, there is something that fixes the reference of my Mentalese concept for Tom—for example, the fact that Tom is the salient person called “Tom.” This reference-fixing fact is not necessarily something I am aware of, which is why it does not qualify as a sense. But it is nonetheless operative in the reference-fixing. When thinking that Tom is generous, I am performing an identification of Tom, albeit an implicit identification, one of which I am not explicitly aware. One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim is that self-reference does not even employ a reference-fixer. It is not only sense-free, but also reference-fixer-free. It is not only that the relevant I-thoughts hook onto oneself without the subject performing an explicit identification, but they hook onto oneself without the subject performing any identification, explicit or implicit. If so, Shoemaker’s claim is more radical than Kripkean direct reference: identification-free reference is not just direct, it is entirely unmediated.

A similar point can be made with respect to Elizabeth Anscombe’s claim that, unlike all other expressions, “I” cannot fail to refer. So I-thoughts are “secure from reference-failure” (Anscombe 1975: 149). That is, such I-thoughts as “I am feeling hungry” are, in effect, immune to error through reference-failure. What is the relation between immunity to error through misidentification and immunity to error through reference-failure? One view would be that there is no difference—the two are the same. But this would make Shoemaker’s ultimate claim that the relevant I-thoughts enjoy identification-freedom the same as Anscombe’s ultimate claim that they enjoy reference-freedom. Shoemaker states explicitly that “I” does refer, though in some identification-free manner. One way to make sense of this is by appeal, again, to freedom from reference-fixing. Here identification-free reference is construed as reference-fixer-free reference. On this view, the Mentalese “I” is referential, but it has the peculiarity that its reference is unmediated by any reference-fixing mechanism.

A crucial issue that remains unaddressed is how reference-fixer-free reference is possible. How can a representational item “find” its referent without any mechanism ensuring a connection between them? Any general theory of self-consciousness that embraces Shoemaker’s IR version of the doctrine of immunity must explain the possibility of reference unfixed. To my knowledge, this challenge remains to be broached in the literature.

b. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts

In the last section we saw that, when one employs the Mentalese “I” in thought, one’s thought probably acquires certain unusual features. In this section, we will see that in certain thoughts one cannot avoid employing the Mentalese “I.” This, too, is a semantic peculiarity, albeit of a different order.

In a well-known story, John Perry tells of his experience following a trail of sugar in a supermarket and thinking to himself “The shopper with the torn bag of sugar is making a mess.” Upon realizing that he is the person with the torn bag, he forms a new thought, “I am making a mess.” This thought is new: its functional role is different from the one of the original thought. Perry’s subsequent actions can be explained by ascribing to him this I-thought in a way they cannot by ascribing to him the “I”-free thought. Perry calls beliefs such as “I am making a mess” locating beliefs, and argues that such beliefs cannot avoid employing Mentalese indexicals. There is no way to think the same thought without employing the Mentalese “I.” Such a thought thus contains an essential indexical, or more accurately, essentially contains an indexical reference. In this sense, these thoughts are irreducible to any other, non-indexical kind of thought.

It should be emphasized that the point here is not that such I-thoughts cannot be reported by anyone other than the subject, or that such first-person reports cannot be matched by third-person reports. In direct speech (oratio recta), one might report Perry’s I-thought as follows:

(1) Perry thinks “I am making a mess”.

The same report could be made more naturally in indirect speech (oratio obliqua). In order to do so, however, one would need to employ what linguists call an indirect reflexive. Some languages apparently contain unique words for the indirect reflexives. English does not. But fortunately, the English indirect reflexives were discerned in the late 1960s by Hector-Neri Castañeda (curiously perhaps, not himself a native speaker). Castañeda showed that (1) is equivalent to:

(2) Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.

At least this is so for paradigmatic uses of “he himself.” (There are also uses of “he” that function in this way, but these are more rare. And there are probably—somewhat unusual—uses of “he himself” that do not function this way. Castañeda introduced the term “he*” as a term that behaves as an indirect reflexive in all its uses.) Castañeda called reports of this sort de se (that is, of oneself) and claimed that de se reports cannot be paraphrased into any de dicto or de re reports, and are thus semantically unique and irreducible. Correlatively, the mental states reported in de se reports, to which we may refer as de se thoughts, are irreducible to mental states reported in de dicto and de re reports. In a “material mode of speech,” this means that states of self-consciousness form an irreducible class of mental states.

Note, in any case, that Castañeda’s thesis is a generalization from Perry’s thesis about reports of one’s own self-conscious states (that is, first-person reports) to all reports of self-conscious states, including reports of others’ self-conscious states (third-person reports). According to Castañeda’s thesis, self-reference is irreducible to either de dicto or de re reference to what is in fact oneself. Castañeda argues for this by showing that the indirect reflexives “he himself,” “she herself,” and so forth, have special logical features. Thus (2) cannot be paraphrased into any (indirect-speech) report that does not employ “he himself.” Consider the following de dicto report:

(3) Perry thinks that the author of “The Essential Indexical” is making a mess.

The truth conditions of (3) and (2) are different, since the latter does not entail the former: Perry may be unaware that it is he who is the author of “The Essential Indexical” (that is, that he himself is the author of “The Essential Indexical”). So (3) and (2) are not equivalent. Presumably, the same goes for any other description “the φ” that picks out Perry uniquely—it could always be that Perry is unaware that he himself is the φ.

Consider next a de dicto report with a proper name instead of a definite description:

(4) Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess.

Again, Perry may be unaware that it is he who is Perry. Therefore, the truth conditions of (2) and (4) are different, and the two are not equivalent. What about the de re versions of (3) and (4)? These can be obtained, in fact, by reading “the author of ‘The Essential Indexical’” and “Perry” in (3) and (4) as used, in Donnellan’s (1966) terms, referentially rather than attributively. But the de re versions are more perspicuously put as follows:

(5) Perry thinks, of the author of “The Essential Indexical,” that he is making a mess.

(6) Perry thinks, of Perry, that he is making a mess.

Boër and Lycan (1980), for instance, claim that (2) is equivalent to (6). But Castañeda argued that it is not. The argument proceeded as follows. The conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists” entails (6), and likewise, the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists” entails (5). But neither the conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists,” nor the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists,” entails (2). Thus, “Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess” and “Perry exists” do not entail “Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.” Therefore, (2) has a different logical force from, and is thus not equivalent to, either (6) or (5). There is perhaps only one approach that may plausibly succeed in reducing de se reports to de dicto ones. It is the approach Eddy Zemach (1985) refers to as neo-Cartesian, and according to which the thought “I am making a mess” is equivalent to:

(7) The thinker of this very thought is making a mess.

On this approach, (2) is equivalent to:

(8) Perry thinks that the thinker of that very thought is making a mess.

In terms of the distinction drawn in §1, the idea here is that self-consciousness is essentially indexical and irreducibly de se inasmuch as it is consciousness of self-as-subject. On this approach, one’s self-conscious thought refers to oneself by referring to itself. In other words, one’s self-reference is mediated by the self-reference of one’s thought.

The emerging view is quite natural. Just as an utterance of the word “I” refers to whoever betokened that very utterance, so a deployment of the Mentalese “I” refers to whoever betokened that very deployment, that is, the thinker of that very I-thought. It may be that “I” is not synonymous with “the utterer of this very word,” but surely the latter functions as the reference-fixer of the former. Likewise, even if the Mentalese “I” is not synonymous with a Mentalese “the thinker of this very thought,” the latter still functions as the reference-fixer of the former.

One problem with the neo-Cartesian approach, however, is that it replaces one sort of indexical self-reference with another. It replaces the thinker’s self-reference with the self-reference of his or her thought. We are thus left with an unexplained essential and irreducible indexical self-reference.

Castañeda actually discussed the neo-Cartesian approach before it was expounded by Zemach, and found a different fault in it. According to Castañeda, what dooms the approach is “the fact, which philosophers (especially Hume and Kant) have known all along, that there is no object of experience that one could perceive as the self that is doing the perceiving” (Castañeda 1966: 64). Whether or not it reflects Hume’s or Kant’s thinking on self-consciousness, the idea is that the subject of thought cannot be thought about as such. Castañeda is effectively denying here the possibility of consciousness of oneself-as-subject. When I think about myself and my mental life, what I am thinking of thereby becomes the object of my thought. I cannot think of myself qua the subject of thought, that is, the thing that does the thinking. The self-as-subject is in this way elusive. As Ryle (1949) put it, trying to think of the self-as-subject is like trying to hop on one’s own shadow: every time you take a step back in order to observe your self-as-subject, your self-as-subject takes a step back with you, as it were.

This objection may apply with more force to what we called in §1 transitive self-consciousness than to what we called intransitive self-consciousness. Even if I cannot become self-conscious of thinking that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful, it does not follow that I cannot self-consciously think that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful. This is because, as pointed out in §1, self-consciously thinking that p, unlike being self-conscious of thinking that p, does not involve two separate states, such that the second one takes the first one as its object. That is, intransitive self-consciousness does not involve “taking a step back,” which is required for Ryle’s regress to get going.

We cannot pursue this issue here with any seriousness. It seems clear, however, that if de se thoughts are not irreducible to de dicto thoughts, it would probably be because the Mentalese “I” can be somehow understood in terms of reference to the subject of the very act of referring. Either way, there is almost certainly some semantic peculiarity to be reckoned with here. The question is merely how best to characterize that peculiarity.

6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?

Discussions of the peculiarities of self-consciousness, both epistemic and semantic, mostly focus on whether a given alleged peculiarity in fact obtains or is merely alleged. But as Brook (2001) stresses, these peculiarities must also be explained, or accounted for, in the context of a general theory of self-consciousness. With a handful of exceptions (for example, Bermúdez 1998) current work on self-consciousness does not appear to address the need for a general theory thereof. Instead, it rests content with a piecemeal treatment of each alleged peculiarity in separation from the rest. Sooner or later, however, this will have to be rectified by a reorientation or reorganization of research in this area.

The alleged peculiarities of self-consciousness will then come in handy. For they are useful in providing explananda for any putative theory of self-consciousness, or data against which to “test” such a theory (this is indeed how Bermúdez 1998 proceeds). This is not to say that they must be the only explananda. Such empirical data as are gleaned from mirror self-recognition experiments and other studies of animal metacognition should also be accommodated by a philosophical theory of self-consciousness.

My suggestion is that a general theory of self-consciousness could be configured in two steps. The first would be to determine which of the alleged epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness in fact obtain. The second would be to devise an account of the metaphysical structure, as well as of the cognitive mechanisms underlying the formation, of states of self-consciousness, such that the relevant account would explain, by predicting or “retrodicting” (as C. S. Peirce puts it), the obtaining of just those peculiarities.

The peculiarities discerned in the second half of the last century are so subtle that we should be open to the idea that there may be further peculiarities which have yet to be “discovered.” There may also be familiar peculiarities that have not been recognized as such. Thus, some recent authors have drawn a new connection between self-consciousness and Moore’s paradox, which presents the challenge of understanding the logical impropriety of beliefs or thoughts of the form “p & I do not believe that p” (see Moran 2001, Kriegel 2004b, and Fernández 2006). Thus it may well be that Moore’s Paradox is at bottom another peculiarity of self-consciousness.

All this suggests that, as far as philosophical research on self-consciousness is concerned, the hardest, but in a way the most interesting, challenges are yet to be faced. At present, the philosophical literature on self-consciousness is quite disparate in the respects mentioned above. But it invites unification under a systematic framework for a general theory of self-consciousness. The most philosophically rewarding work on self-consciousness is still ahead of us.

7. References and Further Reading

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• Bealer, G. 1996. “Functionalism and Self-Consciousness.” Philosophical Review 106: 69-117.
• Bermúdez, J. L. 1998. The Paradox of Self-Consciousness. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
• Boër, S. and W. G. Lycan. 1980. “Who, Me?” Philosophical Review 89: 427-466.
• Boër, S. and W. G. Lycan. 1986. Knowing Who. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
• BonJour, L. 1999. “The Dialectic of Foundationalism and Coherentism.” In J. Greco and E. Sosa (eds.), The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
• BonJour, L. 2001. “Towards a Defense of Foundationalism.” In M. DePaul (ed.), Resurrecting Old-Fashioned Foundationalism. Lanham, MD: Roiwman and Littlefield.
• Brook, A. 2001. “Kant, Self-Awareness and Self-Reference.” In Brook and DeVidi 2001.
• Brook, A. and R. DeVidi (eds.) 2001. Self-Reference and Self-Awareness. Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Co.
• Burge, T. 1988. “Individualism and Self-Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 85: 649-663.
• Campbell, J. 1999. “Schizophrenia, the Space of Reasons and Thinking as a Motor Process.” The Monist 82: 609-625.
• Cassam, Q. (ed.) 1994. Self-Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford UP.
• Cassam, Q. 1997. Self and World. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1966. “‘He’: A Study in the Logic of Self-Consciousness.” Ratio 8: 130-157. Reprinted in Brook and DeVidi 2001.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1967. “The Logic of Self-Knowledge.” Noûs 1: 9-21.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1968. “On the Logic of Attributions of Self-Knowledge to Others.” Journal of Philosophy 65: 439-456.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1969. “On the Phenomno-Logic of the I.” In Proceedings of the 14th International Congress of Philosophy III. Reprinted in Cassam 1994.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1987. “Self-Consciousness, Demonstrative Reference, and the Self-Ascription View of Believing.” Philosophical Perspectives 1: 405-454.
• Chalmers, D.J. 2003. “The Content and Epistemology of Phenomenal Belief.” In Q. Smith and A. Jokic (eds.), Consciousness: New Philosophical Perspectives. Oxford and New York: Oxford UP.
• Chisholm, R. 1976. Person and Object: A Metaphysical Study. London: Allen & Unwin.
• Chisholm, R. 1981. The First Person. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Dennett, D. C. 1991. Consciousness Explained. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
• Donnellan, K. 1966. “Reference and Definite Descriptions.” Philosophical Review 75: 281-304.
• Evans, G. 1982. “Self-Identification.” In his The Varieties of Reference (edited by J. McDowell). Oxford: Oxford UP. Reprinted in Brook and DeVidi 2001.
• Graham, G. and L. Stephens 2000. When Self-Consciousness Breaks: Alien Voices and Inserted Thoughts. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
• Fernández, J. 2003. “Privileged Access Naturalized.” Philosophical Quarterly 53: 352-372.
• Fernández, J. 2006. “Self-Knowledge, Rationality, and Moore’s Paradox.” Forthcoming in Philosophy and Phenomenological Research.
• Fodor, J. A. 1975. The Language of Thought. Cambridge MA: Harvard UP.
• Freud, S. 1915. “The Unconscious.” In his Metapsychological Essays. Trans. J. Strachey. New York: Collier/Macmillan, 1963.
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• Garcia-Carpintero, M. 1998. “Indexicals as Token-Reflexives.” Mind 107: 529-563.
• Geach, P. “On Beliefs about Oneself.” Analysis 18: 23-24.
• Gertler, B. 2001. “Introspecting Phenomenal States.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 63:305-28.
• Gertler, B. 2003. “Self-Knowledge.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Hogan, M. and R. Martin 2001. “Introspective Misidentification: An I for an I.” In Brook and DeVidi 2001.
• Horgan, T., J. Tienson, and G. Graham 2006. “Internal-World Skepticism and the Self-Presentational Nature of Phenomenal Consciousness.” In U. Kriegel and K. Williford (eds.), Self-Representational Approaches to Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Horgan, T. and U. Kriegel 2007. “Phenomenal Epistemology: What is Consciousness that We may Know It so Well?” Forthcoming in Philosophical Issues 17.
• James, W. 1890. The Principles of Psychology (2 volumes). London: McMillan (second edition, 1918).
• James, W. 1961, Psychology: The Briefer Course. Edited by G. Allport. New York: Harper and Row.
• Kapitan, T. 1999. The Ubiquity of Self-Awareness. Grazer Philosophische Studien 57: 17-44.
• Kriegel, U. 2003. “Consciousness as Intransitive Self-Consciousness: Two Views and an Argument.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 33: 103-132.
• Kriegel, U. 2004a. “Consciousness and Self-Consciousness.” The Monist 87: 185-209.
• Kriegel, U. 2004b. “Moore’s Paradox and the Structure of Conscious Beliefs.” Erkenntnis 61: 99-121.
• Lewis, D. 1979. “Attitude De Dicto and De Se.” Philosophical Review 88: 513-543.
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• Van Gulick, R. 1988. “A Functionalist Plea for Self-Consciousness.” Philosophical Review 47: 149-181.
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Author Information

Uriah Kriegel
Email: theuriah@gmail.com
University of Arizona
U. S. A.

Sense-Data

Experiences of all kinds have a distinctive character, which marks them out as intrinsically different from states of consciousness such as thinking. A plausible view is that the difference should be accounted for by the fact that, in having an experience, the subject is somehow immediately aware of a range of phenomenal qualities. For example, in seeing, grasping and tasting an apple, the subject may be aware of a red and green spherical shape, a certain feeling of smoothness to touch, and a sweet sensation. Such phenomenal qualities are also immediately present in hallucinations. According to the sense-data theory, phenomenal qualities belong to items called “sense-data.” In having a perceptual experience the subject is directly aware of, or acquainted with, a sense-datum, even if the experience is illusory or hallucinatory. The sense-datum is an object immediately present in experience. It has the qualities it appears to have.

A controversial issue is whether sense-data have real, concrete existence. Depending upon the version of the sense-data theory adopted, sense-data may or may not be identical with aspects of external physical objects; they may or may not be entities that exist privately in the subject’s mind. Usually, however, sense-data are interpreted to be distinct from the external physical objects we perceive. The leading view, in so far as the notion is appealed to in current philosophy, is that an awareness of (or acquaintance with) sense-data somehow mediates the subject’s perception of mind-independent physical objects. The sense-datum is the bearer of the phenomenal qualities that the subject is immediately aware of.

Knowledge of sense-data has often been taken to be the foundation upon which all other knowledge of the world is based. For a variety of different reasons that will be explored below, the notion of sense-data is now widely held to give rise to a number of difficult, if not insurmountable, problems.

Table of Contents

1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data
2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data
3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data
4. The Objections to Sense-Data
   1. Phenomenological Objections
   2. Coherence Objections
   3. Epistemological Objections
5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data
   1. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea
   2. The Class of Sense-Data
   3. Awareness as a Real Relation
   4. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing
6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions
   1. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism
   2. Adverbialism
   3. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience
7. Critical Realism
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Books and Articles
   2. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data

Sense-data were originally introduced in order to account for a number of puzzling perceptual phenomena. Before we reflect upon the matter, we are inclined to take perception to be direct and straightforward. If I see an apple in front of me in broad daylight, the natural assumption is that the very apple I see is immediately present in my experience. In normal circumstances an object appears as it really is. I believe that the properties I am aware of in my experience, such as the roughly spherical shape, and red and green color, belong to the apple in front of me. There are, however, two main lines of argument that suggest matters are not quite as straightforward as common sense assumes:

The first general type of argument emphasizes epistemological considerations, and focuses on questions about whether our perceptually based claims about the world can be properly justified, and whether, through experience, we can arrive at any knowledge of the world that is beyond doubt. If our goal is to arrive at certain knowledge about the nature of the real world, then one suggestion, in line with empiricist views, is that we should begin with what is immediately given in experience. There are, however, difficulties attaching to the view that our perceptual experiences provide us with knowledge of a mind-independent physical world. It is suggested by advocates of sense-data (and others) that claims about the world that are based upon experience cannot be certain. The reason is that experience is not always a reliable guide to how things really are. Various perceptual phenomena raise prima facie puzzles about how our experiences can give us genuine knowledge of a mind-independent reality.

In perceptual illusions, by definition, some physical object is perceived, but the way an object appears to the perceiving subject is not how it really is. Thus in certain lighting conditions a red object can appear green; a straight stick, half immersed in water, will appear crooked; the whistle of an approaching train sounds a higher pitch than it really is. In hallucinations, there is no object at all present that is relevant to how things appear to a subject: someone who has taken drugs may seem to see a strange animal, when there are no animals present in the vicinity. In double vision, an object appears to be situated in more than one location relative to the subject. In most of these cases we are not usually deceived as to how things really are. However, the fact remains that in such cases things appear differently from the way they really are. These two puzzle cases—illusions and hallucinations–were often assumed to raise epistemological issues, about how we come to have knowledge about the world, and about whether we are justified in the perceptual judgments we make about the physical objects in our surroundings.

One motive, therefore, for introducing the notion of sense-data, involves the epistemic claim that there is a certainty attaching to propositions about experience, which propositions about the physical world are thought to lack. Under the influence of “the argument from illusion” (discussed further below in section 3), some writers argued that the phenomenal qualities that appear immediately to the subject in experience belong to items that are distinct from physical objects. These items are termed sense-data. Propositions about the sense-data immediately present in experience are supposed to have a certainty that other empirical propositions lack.

A second line of thought suggests that the fundamental problems connected with perceptual experience are metaphysical, and concern the proper analysis of what perceptual consciousness involves, and how our perceptual experiences are related to the physical objects and events that we perceive. Reflection upon common sense, and, in particular, upon scientific extensions of common-sense knowledge, raises complex issues concerning the relation between our experiences and the objective world we perceive. When we reflect upon perceptual experience from an external point of view, and think about what is going on when another person is perceiving, then it is natural to conceive of the process of perception as involving a series of distinct, causally related events. In considering a subject of some experiment on vision in a laboratory, we may be lead to distinguish between the fact that an object X is situated in front of the subject, and the inner experience E that the subject has, as a result of looking in the direction of X. This external perspective on perceptual experiences can suggest the thought that perception involves a number of stages, linking what is situated outside the subject by a causal chain of neurophysiological events to the culminating experience E, which perhaps supervenes on the subject’s brain state. We can combine this thought with the idea that an experience of exactly the same type could have been caused in an abnormal manner, without the object X being present – the subject could have had a hallucinatory experience of the same type, supervening upon the same kind of proximal brain state, but triggered by a quite different distal cause, such as, for example, the ingestion of a drug.

This way of considering perception, called by Valberg “The problematic reasoning,” suggests that what a person is immediately consciously aware of in experiencing an object is something logically distinct from that object (Valberg, 1992, ch. 1; see also Robinson, 1994, ch. 6; but compare Martin, 2004). This reasoning is not dependent upon any particular detailed set of scientific theories about perception. It arises at a very general level. But, as Locke appreciated (1690, Book II, Chapter 8), taken in connection with more specific scientific arguments about the intrinsic nature of objects, it can invite the further thought that the properties which the sciences attribute to physical things are very different in kind from the properties we are aware of in experience. For, it might be argued, the properties that science attributes to objects are either basically spatial in nature, or involve special forces and fields (such as electromagnetic phenomena) that we do not observe directly; hence they are distinct from many of the phenomenal qualities that we are immediately aware of. Finally, science tells us that there is a time-lag between the moment of the event at the start of the perceptual chain, when information about the state of a physical object is transmitted to the subject, and the event comprised by the subject experiencing that object. I can, in some sense, see a distant star, even though that star may have ceased to exist before I was born. Thus a second motive for introducing sense-data appeals to the alleged distinction between experiences and the physical objects we perceive. Experiences, on this view, are to be analyzed in terms of the immediate awareness of sense-data.

Both the above lines of thought are supported by some of the phenomenological considerations that relate to our first-person, subjective point of view. The claim that all sense-data belong to the same class of entities, and should collectively be distinguished from physical objects, is based in part upon the supposed fact that experiences of different kinds share a degree of intrinsic resemblance. It is possible for cases of veridical perception, perceptual illusion, and hallucination all to share a subjective similarity. From the standpoint of the subject, such situations are, at least on some occasions, phenomenologically indistinguishable from each other. So, for example, if a person is aware of something red and round, and it seems to them that they are seeing an apple, it is possible that they are actually seeing an apple, or that they are suffering from some illusion, either of a green apple, or of some other object; or they may simply be hallucinating an apple. There may therefore be no physical object situated in the subject’s environment possessing the properties that the subject seems to see. Nevertheless, it seems that the properties of redness and roundness are in some way immediately present to the subject’s experience, in a manner different from belief. On the sense-data view, the experienced properties of visual redness and roundness are attributed to an existing item, a sense-datum, of which the subject is immediately aware, irrespective of whether there exists some matching physical object in the surrounding environment. The postulation of sense-data as items in common to the various kinds of experiences that we can have, whatever their status, explains their subjective similarity.

Considerations such as these, although not always explicitly formulated, nor always clearly distinguished, have prompted the introduction of the notion of “sense-data.” The general idea is that we need first to get clear about precisely what is present in immediate experience whenever we perceive a physical object. We should analyze experience itself, before any assumptions about reality are brought into play.

2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data

Sense-data can be characterized as the immediate objects of the acts of sensory awareness that occur both in normal perception, and also in related phenomena such as illusion and hallucination. The central idea is that whenever I have an experience in which I perceive, or seem to perceive, a physical object, there is something immediately present to my consciousness. This “something” is a distinct object, a sense-datum that I am aware of, which actually has the qualities it appears to have. There is a mental act of awareness that involves a relation to a distinct object (Moore, 1903 and 1913). This act of awareness is sometimes also called an act of “acquaintance” or an act of “apprehension”. Sense-data entities, although often interpreted as non-physical, have real concrete existence; they are not like imaginary objects, such as unicorns, nor like abstract objects, such as propositions.

Suppose, for example, I see, in the ordinary sense of the term, a red apple in normal daylight. Traditionally it has been held that there is a small range of sensible qualities belonging to physical objects that I am aware of immediately, without drawing any inferences (Berkeley, 1713, First Dialogue). Thus, for example, it is held that in seeing the apple, I am immediately aware of its color and shape; in hearing a bell, I am immediately aware of a certain volume, pitch and timbre (or tonal quality) which lead me to believe that I am hearing a bell. Other such sensible qualities include tastes, odors and tangible qualities.

According to the sense-data view, these sensible qualities are in fact phenomenal qualities that belong to the sense-data somehow immediately present to conscious experience. Thus in seeing the apple, I am in fact immediately aware of a visual sense-datum of a certain roughly round shape and red color, which may or may not be identical with some entity in the surrounding world. If I hallucinate a ringing noise in my ear, there exists some sense-datum, a sound that I am immediately aware of. Sense-data can be characterized by a set of determinate qualities belonging to different quality spaces. Visual sense-data thus have color, and also spatial properties, of shape, position, and perhaps also of depth. Auditory sense-data have pitch, volume and timbre, and so on.

There has never been a single universally accepted account of what sense-data are supposed to be; rather, there are a number of closely related views, unified by a core conception. This core conception of a sense-datum is the idea of an object having real existence, which is related to the subject’s consciousness. By virtue of this relation the subject becomes aware that certain qualities are immediately present. This means that sense-data have the following basic characteristics:

In addition, sense-data have often been claimed to have the following characteristics:

Of these, perhaps the most important – and problematic – claim is (e), the idea that being aware of a sense-datum involves some kind of knowledge of facts about the sense-datum (see Sellars, 1956, Part I). Sense-data were originally introduced as the “direct objects” of such acts of awareness as occur in perception and related experiences. Talk of “objects,” it should be noted, is ambiguous. In the sense intended, sense-data are entities that have real existence, of a non-abstract form. This means that sense-data are not like the objects of mental attitudes such as desire, belief, and fear. Such mental attitudes or states are said to have intentional objects, and in so far as the state is concerned, need not be about objects that actually exist. If I am hungry, and desire an apple, and believe incorrectly that there is an apple in the fridge, then although no physical apple exists in the relevant sense, my states are described in terms of what they represent, or are about. The apple, which I falsely believe to exist, in fact lacks real existence, and has only what is called “intentional in-existence,” by virtue of my representing it in my mistaken belief (see Brentano, 1874). But if I see or hallucinate an apple, then according to the sense-data view there is an actual red object of some kind – a sense-datum – that has real existence.

The acts by which the subject is related to sense-data are therefore not representational in the way that thoughts are. They do not have a structure analogous to that of purely intentional states such as desire and belief. So the sense-data theory holds that when the subject has a visual (auditory, and so forth) sensation, there is some real two-term relation of awareness or acquaintance that connects the presented sense-datum to the subject’s mind. The sense-datum is not an abstract object in the way that a proposition is. Nevertheless, this act of awareness is supposed to be, at the same time, a form of direct knowledge of the sense-datum object. It involves some kind of understanding on the subject’s part. Knowledge of the sense-datum is not inferred from any prior conscious state.

Although acts of awareness are mental events in the subject’s mind, the actual sense-datum itself is not a mental item in the way that a pain might be held to be something mental. According to the original formulations of the view, a sense-datum is distinct from the subject’s act of mind, and the subject only becomes aware of it by entering into the unique relation of awareness to it. The sense-datum is therefore not necessarily connected to the subject’s mind: in theory, the sense-datum could exist independently of the subject being aware of it (see below in section 3). Nevertheless, since the awareness of a sense-datum is supposed to be in some sense “immediate,” statements about sense-data have been variously claimed to be indubitable, infallible and incorrigible; there is, however, no settled view as to the status of such claims.

The classical conception of sense-data fits naturally with foundationalist theories of knowledge. Firstly, sense-data can play a role as the entities a subject has some kind of awareness of before arriving at beliefs about anything else: knowledge of sense-data is supposedly antecedent to knowledge of the physical world, and constitutes the justification for beliefs about the existence of physical things. Secondly, sense-data can, on this view, play a role in the empiricist explanation of how, in general, words acquire the meanings they have – the idea being that either words stand directly for properties of sense-data, or can be defined by reference to such words.

3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data

The expression “data of the senses” and its cognates gained currency towards the end of the nineteenth century, particularly in the work of William James (see, for example, James, 1897). The concept of sense-data was refined in the work of Bertrand Russell, and G. E. Moore, prominent amongst the philosophers of this period who appealed to the idea. The view harkens back to the theory of sensory ideas or impressions put forward in the work of empiricist philosophers such as Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. However, Moore’s seminal paper, “The Refutation of Idealism” (1903), which introduced the act-object model of sensing, may be seen as the origin of the essential features of the modern sense-data view. The notion was extensively appealed to in metaphysical and epistemological discussions throughout the first half of the twentieth century, for example in the work of Russell (1912 and 1918), Broad (1925), and Price (1932), and particularly in the works of Ayer (1940, 1956) and other positivistically inclined philosophers.

Since a sense-datum is logically independent of the act of awareness whereby the subject is conscious of it, it follows that sense-data can, in theory, exist outside of consciousness, without any subject being acquainted with them. The general class to which sense-data belong are known as Sensibilia or Sensibles. A sensible becomes a sense-datum by entering into a relation of awareness (or acquaintance) with the mind of a subject. This initial characterization leaves open the precise relation that holds between sense-data and physical objects. The category of sense-data, according to the original formulations of writers such as Russell, Moore and Price, is therefore introduced in an ontologically neutral way (see in particular Moore, 1913; Price, 1932; see also Bermudez, 2000; though compare Broad, 1925).

The answer to the question, “Do sense-data exist?” is therefore complex. Strictly speaking, the answer comprises two stages. In formal terms, if the act-object analysis of experience is correct, it follows from the fact that experiences occur that there are such things as sense-data. Sense-data are the objects, whatever their nature, that are immediately present in experience. Thus, originally, the term sense-data was introduced as a quasi-technical term to help clarify exactly what experience involves, so as to enable us to explore the various puzzling phenomena mentioned above. According to this original conception of sense-data, it is therefore an open question whether sense-data can be identified with physical objects, or their parts (for example, for visual sense-data, the facing surfaces). More usually, however, the question “Do sense-data exist?” is interpreted to mean, “In normal perception, are we aware of sense-data entities that are distinct from mind-independent physical objects?” Given the facts of illusion, and other kinds of perceptual error, it was held by most theorists that sense-data could not be directly identified with ordinary physical objects, conceived of according to common sense; nor, for the same reason, could they be identified with parts of ordinary objects (such as facing surfaces, and so forth).

For many early advocates of the concept, including both Moore and Russell, sense-data were indeed understood to be distinct from physical objects. This treatment of sense-data was bound up with an acceptance of the argument from illusion.

The argument from illusion can be briefly summarized as follows: supposedly, what I am aware of immediately is just how things appear to me. When I see a red physical object that seems green (perhaps because of unusual lighting conditions), some entity exists in the situation that actually is green; it is this green item that is immediately present to my consciousness. Because of the difference in their properties, it would seem to follow that we cannot identify the presented green entity with the red physical object. So what I am immediately aware of is some different entity, a sense-datum, and not a physical object. The existence of such sense-data entities can then be appealed to in order to account for the similarity between veridical and hallucinatory experiences.

A number of replies have been developed to the argument from illusion, and it was debated at great length during the twentieth century (and indeed the argument itself goes back at least as far as Berkeley). A proper appraisal is outside the scope of the present discussion (see in particular Ayer, 1940 and 1967; Austin, 1962; and, for a recent clear and detailed discussion, Smith, 2002). More recently, as noted in Section 1 above, some writers have concentrated upon the causal argument for the introduction of sense-data: this argument suggests that since hallucinatory experiences are in principle subjectively indistinguishable from veridical experiences, all experiences must involve an immediate awareness of entities that belong to the same common kind. There must be a “highest common factor” shared by all experiences. Since I could have a given type of experience – say, of seeming to see a red ball – while hallucinating when no such physical object is present in my surroundings, the common factor cannot include an external physical object. The common factor is therefore interpreted as an experience involving an awareness of sense-data, a special class of entities that are distinct from all external physical objects. For such reasons it can be suggested that in some way the awareness of sense-data is either equivalent to, or supervenes upon, the subject’s brain states alone. Even in veridical perception the subject immediately experiences sense-data that are distinct from the distal object perceived (Grice, 1961; Valberg, 1992; and Robinson, 1994).

If sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, and it is held that they can never be identified with the ordinary physical objects outside the subject’s body, then the question arises as to how in fact sense-data are related to the physical objects that we assume make up the external world. According to the Causal Theory of Perception (sometimes called the “Representative Theory,” or “Indirect Realism”) sense-data are caused by the physical objects that in some sense we perceive, perhaps indirectly, in our local surroundings. When I see an apple, that apple causes me to be immediately aware of a sense-datum of a red and green round shape, a sense-datum that roughly “corresponds” to the facing surface of the real physical apple. Some writers have objected to the Causal Theory on epistemic grounds. It has sometimes been claimed that physical objects are made unknowable on the causal account, or that demonstrative reference to physical objects would not be possible if the theory was correct (for discussion see Price, 1932; Armstrong, 1961; and Bermudez, 2000; but for replies to this criticism compare Grice, 1961, and Jackson, 1977).

Another possibility, explored particularly by Russell, was the metaphysical thesis that sense-data might be equated with the ultimate constituents of the world. If sense-data can be understood in this way, then both ordinary common-sense objects, and hallucinatory images, might be constructed from them; and possibly even the self might be a logical construction out of such entities. Under the influence of the theory developed by William James known as “Neutral Monism,” Russell analyzes a physical object such as a chair as a series of classes of sense-data; the self is also analyzed in a parallel way, as a distinct series of classes of sense-data, some of which include the sense-data that make up the chair (Russell, 1918, Lecture viii). (What this view means, very roughly, is that sense-data are taken to be the basic constituents of the world. Statements about selves, and about physical objects, are supposed to be definable in terms of statements about sense-data, in much the same way that it might be held that statements about nations might be defined in terms of statements about lands and inhabitants.)

Other writers put forward the related theory of phenomenalism, a view which was first developed in detail by John Stuart Mill, although it was in fact briefly canvassed by Berkeley (1710, sec 3). According to phenomenalism, physical objects are thought of as constructions out of actual and possible sense-data. That is, a statement asserting the existence of a given particular physical object, such as an apple in front of me, is supposed to be analyzable in terms of statements about the sense-data experiences I am currently having of the apple, or that I would have if I were to reach out and pick it up. To say that there is an apple unperceived in the fridge is to say something like: “If I were to open the door of the fridge and if my eyes were open, etc, I would have sense-data of a reddish, apple-like shape, and so forth.” The idea is that any statement that on the surface appears to be about a physical object can, by analogous methods, be translated into a set of statements which refer only to actual and possible sense-data, and do not refer to physical objects. But how to fill out the phenomenalist analysis in a more detail, so as to avoid any circularity (and to remove any appeal to the “et ceteras”) becomes problematic: in the example briefly sketched above, the analysis of the unperceived apple makes reference to the fridge door, and also to my own bodily states, and hence is incomplete (for a discussion see Chisholm, 1957; Urmson, 1956).

A different, though related approach to the question, put forward in various forms by Ayer, held that there was no genuine problem about the ontological status of sense-data and their relation to physical objects. We should instead regard the issue as a question of finding the most useful convention for discussing the various facts relating to perceptual phenomena. According to this view, acceptance of the sense-data theory amounts to a decision to employ a certain terminology, without deep consequences for metaphysics and epistemology. Provided suitable adjustments were made elsewhere in one’s system, any theory of perception could be adopted. Alternative theories “are, in fact what we should call alternative languages” (Ayer, 1940; similar ideas were mooted by Paul, 1936). Ayer’s own preferred language was in fact very close to the phenomenalist analysis sketched above.

The idea of sense-data came under attack from three general directions: (i) from phenomenologically based criticisms, drawing upon some of the findings of Gestalt psychology (for example, Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949/50); (ii) from anti-foundationalist views emanating from the philosophy of science, which denied a clear-cut distinction between observation and theory (for example, Hanson, 1958), and (iii) from the standpoint of ordinary language philosophy and epistemology (for example, in the powerful critique presented by Austin, 1962). As a result of these combined attacks, in the second half of the twentieth century the notion fell into disuse, despite some careful subsequent defences of the idea (see, for example: Ayer, 1967; Sprigge, 1970; and Jackson, 1977). Nevertheless, although explicit appeal to the notion has now largely been abandoned, the core conception still exerts a powerful influence upon our ways of thinking about perception in particular and epistemology in general.

4. The Objections to Sense-Data

Objections to the view that sense-data exist in a form that is different from the existence of ordinary physical objects have been advanced on a number grounds. These objections fall into three broad categories.

a. Phenomenological Objections

There is a central phenomenological objection to the idea of sense-data, which can be formulated in various ways. The basic contention is that the postulation of sense-data entities runs counter to ordinary perceptual experience. My immediate experience, when in the normal case I look around me, consists in the awareness of “full-bodied physical objects” (Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949; see also the discussion in Austin, 1962). First-person perceptual judgments are not mediated; I am not aware of making inferences from a subjective awareness of sense-data to the objective judgments I form about physical objects.

b. Coherence Objections

Perceptual experience is indeterminate. If I briefly see a speckled hen, I see that it has some speckles, but I am not aware of it as having a definite number of speckles. According to the sense-data view, the sense-datum of the hen I am aware of necessarily has the properties it appears to have. Hence the sense-datum of the hen has an indeterminate number of speckles. Yet if what I am aware of when I see the hen is a visual shape, an actual existing speckled sense-datum, then surely it must have a determinate number of speckles; this seems to lead to the contradiction in the properties that we attribute to the sense-datum (Barnes, 1944; but compare Jackson, 1977).

There are no clear-cut identity conditions for sense-data, and hence no principled grounds for answering such questions as, how many visual sense-data are present in my visual field? How long do they last? To this objection the sense-data theorist might well reply that in this respect sense-data are not logically worse off than many other kinds of entity; the identity conditions of ordinary physical objects are similarly not clear-cut (Jackson, 1977).

A further problem consists in saying where sense-data exist. Are they in some private space of which only the subject can be aware? Or do they exist in physical space? If the former, we need to explain how private subjective spaces are related to a common public space. If the latter, then we need to provide some account of how the properties of sense-data relate to those of the physical objects which are situated at the same location (Barnes, 1944).

Upholding the sense-data theory has sometimes been held to entail an acceptance of the idea of a “Private Language,” a view that Wittgenstein argued to be incoherent. Wittgenstein’s views on this question are not easy to interpret, and a full assessment of them is outside of the scope of this article. He was prepared to accept the existence of inner states and processes, provided they were connected with outer criteria (Wittgenstein, 1953, remark 580, and footnote to 149). Other passages (such as 1953, remarks 398-411) suggest that the real target of his criticism is the “act-object” model of experience. If Wittgenstein’s ideas are accepted, this would appear to show the incoherence any foundationalist conception of sense-data, in which knowledge of sense-data precedes, and serves as the basis for other forms of knowledge (see also Sellars, 1956 and 1963).

Perhaps the most fundamental of the objections to the coherence of the notion of sense-data concerns the unique “act-object” relation that is supposed to link the sense-datum to the subject’s consciousness. Crucially, the nature of this relation is left unexplained. Attempts to explain the relation, it is claimed, lead to a regress (Ryle, 1949, ch. 7; Kirk, 1994). This objection is discussed more fully below, in section 5c.

c. Epistemological Objections

There is a general worry, originating in the work of Descartes and Locke, that the acceptance of entities equivalent to sense-data, when these are interpreted as distinct from physical objects, leads to problems in the theory of knowledge. If we are only aware of sense-data, and not of the physical objects themselves, how can we be sure that the properties of physical objects resemble those that appear to us? How can we even be sure that physical objects do exist? Isn’t the sense-data theorist saddled with a serious and insoluble sceptical problem about the external world? The acceptance of sense-data, it is argued, leads inevitably to idealism or scepticism. Such criticisms have been widely advanced, but it is not at all clear how cogent they are. On any theory of perception problems about the relation between appearance and reality can be raised; they do not attach only to the sense-data view (for some discussion, see: Armstrong, 1961; Jackson, 1977; Robinson, 1994; M. Williams, 1996).

5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data

a. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea

Advocates of sense-data have produced many responses to these specific objections to sense-data. But no adequate assessment is possible without a proper examination of the underlying features of the original sense-datum theory, which give rise to the various difficulties listed. All the objections above trace back to deeper tensions arising from three central claims that form part of the original conception of sense-data. These are first summarized, before being subjected to a closer examination:

Claim 1: Sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, whose members can in principle exist independently of acts of awareness:

Claim 2: The awareness of a sense-datum is a sui generis act of awareness, involving a two-term real relation between an act of mind and a particular existent:

Claim 3: The awareness of a sense-datum is a form of sensory experience that somehow provides the subject directly with knowledge of facts about the sense-datum:

These three features of the sense-datum theory will be examined in turn.

b. The Class of Sense-Data

Do all sense-data, defined merely as the objects of immediate awareness in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences, belong to the same ontological category? This question leads to a number of further questions: How are sense-data related to physical objects? Are some of the sense-data that occur in ordinary veridical perception identical with the ordinary physical objects we perceive, or are they in all cases distinct from them? Can sense-data have properties of which the subject is not aware?

Assuming that we can make sense of the idea of acts of awareness, and that the formal notion of sense-data as the objects of such acts can be given a clear meaning, the precise ontological status of sense-data is a further issue, a matter of some debate. It should not be assumed without further argument that they constitute a homogenous class, and that, for example, the type of sense-datum present in a hallucination is of the same type as that present in the veridical experience of an external physical object. As we have noted, in the original formulations of the concept, sense-data are initially introduced in a neutral way – the idea being that their exact ontological status is a matter to be investigated. As a consequence of the adoption of the act-object conception of awareness, sense-data are held to be, in an important way, distinct from the subject’s mind. To the extent that a sense-datum is present to experience, and the subject is aware of that sense-datum as having a property F, it follows that the sense-datum must have that property F; but arguably it is possible that the sense-datum also has some other property G of which the subject is not aware (Moore, 1918; Ayer 1945; and Jackson, 1977). It is therefore possible that, in veridical perception, what the subject is immediately aware of is a sense-datum that is in fact identical with a physical object, whereas in hallucinations the sense-data present are non-physical items (Bermudez, 2000).

c. Awareness as a Real Relation

How can the nature of the relation involved between the act of awareness and the sense-datum be further characterized? How is the intrinsic nature of the subject’s experience (in so far as this involves the very act itself) related to the properties possessed by the existing sense-datum object? Should the sense-datum present in experience be understood as a particular entity, distinct from the act of awareness (or acquaintance), or should it be analyzed as an aspect of the character of the act?

One of the most serious objections raised against the whole notion of sense-data is that the nature of the relation between the subject’s conscious act of awareness and the sense-datum object is obscure, and cannot be coherently explicated. If the relation is modeled upon perceiving, then the view leads to an infinite regress. For suppose we try to analyze the situation where S sees some physical object X by the postulation of an additional entity, a sense-datum Y, such that in seeing X, S is directly aware of the sense-datum Y; suppose further, that the relation of direct awareness of a sense-datum is explained as similar to the relation of seeing an object; then by a like argument, in order to explain how S can be aware of the sense-datum Y, it seems that we must postulate a third entity Z, in order to account for the relation of S to Y, and so on ad infinitum. Of course, this regress can be blocked by denying that “awareness” (or “acquaintance”) is to be understood by analogy to perceiving, but this then leaves the nature of the awareness relation unexplained; all that can be said is that the relation of awareness is unanalyzable (Ryle, 1949; Kirk, 1994).

The problem here is exacerbated by the fact that such acts of awareness also have a peculiar metaphysical character that distinguishes them in general from other kinds of acts. Although the act is supposed to involve a two-term relation connecting two particulars, it also functions as a unique kind of “bridge” or link between consciousness and external items supposedly distinct from the mind. But it is hard to make sense of the claim that act and object are distinct entities. The act of awareness mysteriously “conveys” the phenomenal qualities of the object over to the conscious mind of the subject, making them present on the mental side of the relation, in the subject’s experience. It is not clear how any relation could play this role.

Connected with these problems is the issue of the status in the subject’s consciousness of the alleged acts of awareness. Moore himself drew attention to the fact that when I try to focus upon my act of awareness, all that I am aware of is the object of that act; I am not in any direct way conscious of the act itself. The act of awareness is supposed to be “transparent” or “diaphanous”: it is not something that is present in consciousness, when the subject is aware of its object. Introspection is of no help here, for even when I introspect I cannot discern anything other than the object I am aware of in having an act, the sense-datum. For example, when I see the oval petal of a blue flower, I am, supposedly, directly aware of a blue, oval shaped sense-datum. All that closer introspection of my consciousness reveals is just the very same blue oval shape that was there in the first place. So what grounds are there for saying that acts take place, acts that are distinct from their objects?

The act-object conception of the awareness of sense-data is also connected with a fundamental tension in the notion, concerning the extent to which the subject becomes aware of all and only the properties of the sense-datum. The tension is between the idea that the sense-datum has just those properties of which the subject is immediately aware of in being aware of the sense-datum, and the idea that there are further properties that belong to the sense-datum independently of whether the subject is aware of them. This tension leads to contradictory claims about the status of sense-data. Thus Russell held that sense-data are private to the subject (1914); more consistently, Moore held that it was an open question whether sense-data were private – this was not a feature of sense-data that followed automatically from the definition of the notion (1918). One attempt to avoid these various difficulties is the adverbial analysis of experience, discussed below in section 6b.

d. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing

In what way does an act of awareness, whereby a sense-datum entity is experienced, involve knowledge of the particular sense-datum that is present? How is the phenomenal (or sensory) aspect of experience related to the employment of concepts when the subject attends to the sense-datum and is aware of it as belonging to a certain kind?

Arguably the most fundamental difficulty arising from the notion of sense-data is the extent, and manner, in which concepts are involved in the awareness of a sense-datum. As Sellars pointed out, in many writings on sense-data there was an equivocation between treating the awareness of sense-data as, (i) an extensional non-epistemic relation between the mind and an independent existing entity, or alternatively, (ii) as a form of knowing (see, in particular, Sellars, 1956). On the former view, being aware of a sense-datum is an extensional relation; the subject is related by awareness to a real entity that has concrete (as opposed to abstract) existence. On this view, being aware of a sense-datum is not a form of knowledge; it is more like a state of raw, unconceptualized sensation. The emphasis is simply upon the qualitative nature of phenomenal experience. But, on the alternative interpretation, the awareness of sense-data as a treated as a cognitive state or process, in which the mind attends to and grasps what is immediately before it, in a manner that somehow involves a classification into kinds. On this later epistemic view, the awareness of a sense-datum seems to require the exercise of concepts of at least a low-level kind.

Russell was happy to classify the direct awareness relation of the mind to a particular existing object as knowledge. This form of knowledge was not considered by Russell to be propositional, although it did involve attention (Russell, 1914). However, if the view is taken that all knowing involves classification, and hence the use of concepts, the issue is not so clear, as C. I. Lewis pointed out in presenting an alternative to the sense-data account, a neo-Kantian dual-component view of experience (Lewis, 1929). If the fact that something seems red to me is accounted for by my having knowledge by awareness of a red visual sense-datum, this suggests that I am aware of it as red, and this seems to require that I have the concept of redness. Equally, for a subject to attend to a particular entity suggests that the subject is able to single out that entity out by virtue of being aware of certain of its properties, which seems again to require the use of sortal concepts, so that the subject can conceive of the object as a unity.

According to Wilfrid Sellars (1956, Part I), the classical sense-data theorists’ conception of awareness (or acquaintance) is an amalgam of two different lines of thought: first, that there is some phenomenal or sensory aspect that distinguishes states of perceiving or seeming to perceive from states of merely believing or thinking, and second, that there are non-inferential knowings, knowings not based immediately on any particular prior beliefs, which operate as the foundation or evidence for all other empirical claims. In order to begin to clarify the distinct issues involved, Sellars holds that we need to distinguish more clearly between (a) the phenomenal or sensory aspects presented in experience, and (b) the concepts (perhaps of a low-level sort), inclinations to form beliefs, and other intentional aspects of experience.

These points about the distinction between the phenomenal and conceptual aspects of experience are connected with the interpretation of the awareness of a sense-datum as a two-place relation between act and object, albeit an act of a non-intentional kind connecting two existing relata. In some manner knowledge originates in, and is intimately tied up with the conceptual aspects of perceptual experiences. Having a perceptual experience usually leads to a “perceptual thought,” an intentional state. Yet this fact does not necessarily imply that the phenomenal aspect of perceptual experience should itself be analyzed on the model of intentional acts, such as thoughts about states of affairs. Many of the objections listed above, particularly those pertaining to the internal coherence of the notion, stem from the conflation of sensing and knowing – a “mongrel” conception, as Sellars describes it, in which phenomenal consciousness is equated directly with conceptual consciousness (Sellars, 1956, Part I).

A related issue is the problem of how the term “immediately” is to be understood in attempts to explicate the notion of sense-data. The term is sometimes understood in a psychological sense, as connected with how things appear from a subjective point of view. The idea is that sense-data may be viewed as “immediate objects” of perception, in the sense that awareness of them is not inferred from any belief, and that sense-data, as defined, have a fixed small set of qualities. But then it can be objected that the sense-data view is simply false to experience: what I am usually immediately aware of when I look at an apple is just the apple itself, and not a simply a patch of color with a certain shape (Heidegger, 1968; Firth, 1949, 1950; Valberg, 1993). It is the notion of there being an apple in front of me that springs immediately to my mind when I see it – my mind is occupied with concepts relating to the physical object framework. Discerning the actual complex pattern of color and shape given to me in experience is something that requires special training and attention. Similar criticisms affect the closely related attempts to introduce the notion of sense-data by appeal to ideas such as certainty or indubitability (Price, 1932).

If the awareness of sense-data in itself is not a conceptual or propositional state, the question of inference or otherwise does not arise. A perceptual belief about the kind of object experienced would simply be causally related to a prior state of phenomenal consciousness. So, for example, it might be claimed that the non-conceptual awareness of a sense-datum prompts the subject to form a thought about the kinds of properties they are experiencing. If, alternatively, awareness is construed as propositional in nature, then this seems to undermine the original conception of sense-data as accounting for the distinctive phenomenal, or sensory, aspects of experience.

6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions

Many of the major subsequent developments in the philosophical treatment of perceptual experience can be seen as attempts to grapple with the tensions in the original notions of sense-data. Different lines of thought have been developed, according to which particular problem has been considered most pressing. There are four important approaches to the question of how perceptual experience should be analyzed that are particularly worthy of note.

a. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism

In recent times a number of philosophers have rejected the homogeneity assumption. They argue that there is no single common type of presented entity in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences. A claim of the form: “It looks to subject S as if there is an F present…” can be made true by virtue of two quite different situations. The objects that perceiving subjects are immediately acquainted with in normal veridical perception are just the very physical objects that common sense tells us exist. There are no other entities involved as perceptual intermediaries. In other kinds of case, such as hallucinations, and possibly also illusions, there may be non-physical entities present in consciousness that are in some sense qualitatively similar to physical objects, but this subjective fact does not mean that there is a deeper similarity at the ontological level. In refusing to allow any role for perceptual intermediaries in the normal case, this view amounts to the general theory of perception known as Direct Realism: veridical perception is understood to comprise a direct relation of awareness between a conscious subject and an object or feature of the external physical world. The perceptual experience of a physical object is a “simple relation” holding between subject and object (see, for example, Barnes 1940; Dretske, 1969; and Campbell, 2002). In virtue of its denial of a “highest common factor” shared by different kinds of experiences (see above, section 3d), Direct Realism has also been described as a form of “Disjunctivism,” although this latter term can have other connotations in connection with theories of perception (see Snowdon, 1980; and also Martin, 2002).

Direct Realism involves a rejection of the Causal Theory of Perception, where the latter theory is understood as attempting to reductively analyze perceiving into separate components, involving an experience that is logically distinct from (though causally related to) the object perceived. The Direct Realist view, however, still encounters the remaining two problems for the sense-datum theory highlighted above. In particular, clarification is required of nature of the non-causal simple relation of awareness that holds in the normal perceptual case. How does an external physical object, by virtue of causally connecting with the subject’s sensory systems, come to stand in a relation to the subject’s consciousness, in such a manner that the perceiver is made immediately aware of phenomenal qualities belonging to that object? In the absence of a positive account, the simple perceiving relation remains obscure, and the grounds for introducing it are unclear (Coates, 1998 and 2007). A further problem for this view is to make sense of the phenomenal or sensory similarity between the entities that occur in hallucinations and the objects that we are aware of in illusions and ordinary perception. We need to account for the fact that the sense-data which occur in hallucinations have phenomenal qualities that resemble those which occur in the direct perception of the sensible properties of physical objects. This problem becomes the more acute, to the extent that a scientific conception of objects and their properties is accepted.

b. Adverbialism

In an attempt to avoid the difficulty in providing a satisfactory explication of the nature of the awareness relation, it has been argued that appearances should be should be construed “adverbially” as states of the perceiving subject, rather than as involving a two-place relation (Ducasse, 1952; Chisholm, 1957). According to this view, it is more perspicuous to analyze certain types of statements, statements apparently about sense-datum particular entities and their properties, as implicit claims about the manner in which a subject experiences or senses. The relational interpretation of appearances should be abandoned.

According to this account, the awareness of an appearance of a certain kind should be modeled on the awareness of pains – pains are not distinct from experience, they are properties of experience. Whereas Moore held that, in seeing a red rose, the subject is acquainted with a red sense-datum that is distinct from the subject’s act of consciousness, on the adverbial view the sensation of red is construed as a state of the subject’s consciousness.

So a claim such as:

(a) S is aware of a red visual sense-datum

is to be analyzed by:

(b) S visually senses redly.

The idea is that (b) reveals more perspicuously the underlying logical form of the original claim (a).

As sketched out in this simple model, however, the proposed analysis is clearly defective. For we need to account for the way that more complex patterns of appearances are to be analyzed.

Suppose:

(c) S seems to see one object that is red and round and another distinct object that is blue and square.

For the sense-data theorist, there would be two sense-data involved, corresponding to the two objects apparently seen, with analogous properties; thus (c) would be analyzed along the lines of:

(d) S is aware of one sense-datum x that is red and round, and another sense-datum y that is blue and square.

But the simple adverbial view is unable to solve the problem of what “binds” the apparent properties together in the complex appearance presented to the subject. The only analysis forthcoming is:

(e) S visually senses redly and roundly and bluely and squarely

yet analysis (e) fails to distinguish between the initial appearance (c) above, and the quite different overall appearance, where the links between the properties are changed:

(f) S seems to see one object which is red and square and another object that is blue and round

Hence the adverbial view must at a minimum allow a subdivision of the contents of the subject’s mind into distinct states of sensing (Jackson, 1977; see also W. Sellars, 1982). So (c) now becomes analyzed as involving a state1 of sensing redly and roundly, and a distinct state 2 of sensing bluely and squarely. State 1 and state 2 should be construed as different aspects of a single subject, or as co-constituents in the subject’s mind. However, in whatever precise form the adverbial view is developed, it still leaves unresolved the issue of the way in which concepts are involved in perceptual experience.

c. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience

One other important development that took place towards the end of the twentieth century concerned what has become known variously as the representationalist view of experience, or as the intentional view (or intentionalism). This amounts to interpreting experience as a unitary representational state; seeing, hearing, etc, are fully intentional states whose structures in some way parallel that of thinking and desiring. The acts of awareness or sensing are interpreted no longer as involving relations to non-abstract existing entities, but are instead understood as involving special attitudes towards states of affairs that may or may not exist.

One extreme reductive version of this view was put forward by D. Armstrong (1961), who tried to analyze perceiving purely in terms of the acquisition of beliefs and inclinations to believe. An alternative non-reductive version was advanced originally by Anscombe (1965), and has been taken up in various forms subsequently by a number of writers. On this version, the phenomenal content of perceptual experience is distinguished from the intentional content of thoughts and beliefs, but is still understood to be intrinsically representational. For Anscombe, and others who adopt this view, experiences represent facts in a special sensory manner. A question such as, “What did the subject see?” can be interpreted either extensionally, as asking about the actual physical object seen – the material object – or intensionaly, as concerned with the way in which things looked to the subject. When we describe how things look to the subject, we characterize the content of the perceptual experience by reference to the subject’s viewpoint, and such descriptions need not be true of the material object, which is physically present in front of the perceiver. So the descriptions involved give the intentional object of sensation, but need not refer to any actual existing item. The intentional object of sensation has no more reality than the fictional object of thought that is involved in my thought about “Zeus.” Something like this intentionalist interpretation of experience has been associated with an alternative form of Disjunctivism (McDowell, 1982, 1986 and 1998; Snowdon, 1980; Harman, 1990, and many other authors).

A major problem for this view is to give a satisfactory account of the difference between the content of an experience such as: “seeming to see that there is something white nearby,” and the parallel thought: “thinking that there is something white nearby,” which has the same intentional content, describable in identical terms. I can seem to see that there is something white in front of me, and I can think that there is something white in front of me; when I compare the two states, I am subjectively aware that there is a vivid difference in my consciousness, even though I am representing the same states of affairs. If experiences and thoughts can have completely matching contents, there must be some further, independent feature of my consciousness in virtue of which they differ. It is not clear whether the representational view really does justice to the way in which experiences involve phenomenal or sensory qualities actually present in consciousness.

Some writers claim that the representational content of experience is non-conceptual, meaning that the subject need not exercise the concepts necessary to characterize the experiences they have (Tye, 1995 and 2000). There is an important ambiguity here in the term “non-conceptual.” This can be understood in something like functional terms, as relating to the way such states guide primitive or semi-automatic actions in creatures lacking fully conceptual states – in which case a nonconceptual state can be distinct from the phenomenal character of experience, and cannot help to explain the nature of the later. Alternatively, “non-conceptual” can be understood as relating to phenomenal consciousness, the feature that makes the difference between mere thought and experience. But then it is of no help simply to be told that this feature is representational in a nonconceptual sense – we are still stuck with the problem that the representational contents of experience and thought can in some cases match, and what has to be explained is the nature of the difference between them. We require an account of the difference between the way that perceptual content represents and mere thought represents. It is arguable that the difference between them involves some intrinsic phenomenal aspect of consciousness, something actually present in experience that has more reality than a merely fictional object like “Zeus.” As Geach notes, sensations have formal as well as representational properties (Geach, 1957, section 28). It is not clear that the parallel between perceptual experience and thought has been successfully made out on the intentionalist view (compare also Martin 2002).

7. Critical Realism

A final possibility that has been canvassed is some form of dual-component analysis of perceptual consciousness, which attempts to do justice to both the phenomenal (or sensory) aspects, and also the conceptual aspects involved in experience. Perceptual experience is analyzed as involving two quite different components: an intentional component involving the representation of the subject’s surrounding environment through the exercise of classificatory concepts (perhaps of a low-level kind), and a further non-intentional and non-conceptual phenomenal state, in virtue of which phenomenal qualities are made present in the subject’s experience. Although the phenomenal non-conceptual component is not understood as intrinsically representational in the way that a thought is, it can still be treated as in a weak sense representational; that is, the different aspects of the phenomenal component of experience can still be described as carrying informational content about those features of the environment that normally cause them to arise in the subject’s experience, and are thus identified by reference to physical states of affairs.

A dual component view can take many different forms. Indeed, acceptance of it is implicit on some versions of direct and naïve realism. But of course it can also be combined with versions of the Causal Theory of Perception, in which the subject’s whole experience is held to be in an important sense distinct from the object perceived. One leading exponent of this view was Wilfrid Sellars, who developed the Critical Realist view originally put forward by the group that included his father Roy Wood Sellars, G. Santayana, and A. O. Lovejoy (for the original statement of Critical Realism, see Drake (ed.), 1920). Sense-data are re-interpreted as phenomenal or sensory states of the subject; but this aspect is no longer analyzed as having an act-object form. Sense-data awareness is replaced by a type of one-place sensing state, a constituent or aspect of the subject’s mind, and such awareness does not involve a real relation between an act and a distinct object. This sensing (or phenomenal) state causally prompts a perceptual thought (or a “perceptual taking,” involving low level classification), which is an intentional state, directed on to objects in the external world. The experience as a whole – involving a phenomenal state, and also the exercise of concepts – is causally related to the physical object perceived (W. Sellars, 1956, 1977, 1982).

The distinctive feature of the critical realist account is the claim that the phenomenal aspect of experience guides perceptual thoughts directly about the objects perceived; importantly, such perceptual thoughts are not in normal cases of perception focused on the phenomenal state – they refer directly to the physical objects we think we see in our surroundings. In seeing an apple, I sense in a red and round manner, and this guides my perceptual thought that there is an apple in front of me. On this analysis of perception, the sense-data theorist is viewed as guilty of a psychological error, as well as a philosophical one: we do not form perceptual thoughts directly about our own subjective phenomenal states. Entities with some of the characteristics traditionally attributed to sense-data are held to exist in experience, but they should not to be identified with the objects of perception.

Sellars’ own view was originally formulated in the context of a complex overall account of the nature of language and the way in which we come to refer to mental states such as thought and sensing, and underwent important developments in later work. But an acceptance of something like the central Critical Realist thought can be seen in the work of many recent writers on perception (including, for example, Grice, 1961; Mackie, 1976; Millar 1991; and Lowe, 1992). One problem for the Critical Realist view consists in reconciling the duality of experience posited by the account with the phenomenological sense that there is a unity in experience. A second problem lies in showing how the subject’s perceptual judgments succeed in referring to objects that are not immediately present in consciousness.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Books and Articles

• Anscombe, G. E. M., “The Intentionality of Sensation,” in Butler, R., (ed.) Analytical Philosophy: Second Series, Blackwell, Oxford, pp. 158-180, 1965.
• Armstrong, D., Perception and the Physical World, Routledge, London, 1961.
• Austin, J. L., Sense and Sensibilia, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1962.
• Ayer, A. J., Language Truth and Logic, Camelot Press, London, 1936.
• Ayer, A. J., Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1940.
• Ayer, A. J., “The Terminology of Sense-Data,” Mind, 54, pp. 289-312, 1945.
• Ayer, A. J., The Problem of Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1956.
• Ayer, A. J., “Has Austin Refuted the Sense-Datum Theory?,” Synthese, 17, pp. 117-40, 1967.
• Barnes, W. F., “The Myth of Sense-Data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 45, 1944.
• Berkeley, George, Principles of Human Knowledge, 1710.
• Berkeley, George, Three Dialogues Between Hylas and Philonous, 1713.
• Bermudez. J., “Naturalized Sense-data,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 61, pp. 353-74, 2000.
• Brentano, F., Psychology From an Empirical Standpoint, Dunker and Humblot, Leipzig, 1874.
• Broad, C. D., The Mind and its Place in Nature, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1925.
• Campbell, J. Reference and Consciousness, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 2002.
• Chisholm, R., Perceiving, Cornell University Press, Ithaca, 1957.
• Coates, P., “Perception and Metaphysical Scepticism,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 72, pp. 1-28, 1998.
• Coates, P., The Metaphysics of Perception, Routledge, London, 2007.
• Drake, D., (ed.), Essays in Critical Realism, Macmillan, London, 1920.
• Dretske, F., Seeing and Knowing, Routledge, London, 1969.
• Ducasse, C. J., Nature, Mind and Death, LaSalle, Illinois, 1951.
• Firth, R., “Sense-Data and the Percept Theory,” Mind, 58 & 59, 1949/1950; reprinted in Swartz, R., (ed.) Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, New York, pp. 204-270, 1965.
• Geach, P., Mental Acts, Routledge, London, 1957.
• Grice, H. P., “The Causal Theory of Perception,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
• Hanson, N. R., Patterns of Discovery, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1958.
• Harman, G., “The Intrinsic Qualities of Experience,” in Philosophical Perspectives, 4: Action, Theory and Philosophy of Mind, 1990.
• Heidegger, M., What Is Called Thinking?, tr. J. Glenn Gray, Harper and Row, New York, 1968.
• Jackson, F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1977.
• James, W., “The Sentiment of Rationality,” Mind, 1897, reprinted in his Essays on Pragmatism, Hafner Press, New York, pp. 3-36, 1948.
• Kirk, R., Raw Feeling, Oxford, Clarendon Press, 1994.
• Lewis, C. I., Mind and the World Order, Charles Scribner’s Sons, New York, 1929.
• Locke, John, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, 1690; ed. Nidditch, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1975.
• Lowe, E., “Experience and its Objects” in Crane, T., (ed.) The Contents of Experience, pp. 79-104, 1992.
• Mackie, J., Problems From Locke, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1976.
• Martin, M. “The Transparency of Experience,” Mind & Language, 17, pp. 376-425, 2002.
• Martin, M., “The Limits of Self-Awareness,” Philosophical studies, 120, pp. 37-89, 2004.
• Millar, A., Reasons and Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1991.
• Moore, G. E., “The Refutation of Idealism,” Mind, 12, 1903; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
• Moore, G. E., “The Status of Sense-data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1913; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, (1922).
• Moore, G. E., “Some Judgements of Perception,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1918; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
• Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1922.
• Merleau-Ponty, M., Phenomenology of Perception, tr. Colin Smith, Routledge, London, 1945/1962.
• McDowell, J., “Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge” in Proceedings of the British Academy, 68, pp. 455-79, 1982.
• McDowell, J., “Having the World in View: Sellars, Kant, and Intentionality,” Journal of Philosophy, pp. 431-491 (The Woodbridge Lectures), 1998.
• Paul, G., “Is there a Problem About Sense-data?” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 15, pp. 61-77, 1936.
• Price, H. H., Perception, Methuen, London, 1932.
• Robinson, H., Perception, Routledge, London, 1994.
• Russell, B., The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
• Russell, B., “The Relation of Sense-data to Physics,” Scientia, 4, 1914; reprinted in Russell, B., Mysticism and Logic, Unwin Books, London, 1917.
• Russell, B., “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism,” 1918, reprinted in Logic and Knowledge, Marsh, R., (ed.), Allen and Unwin, London, 1956.
• Ryle, G., The Concept of Mind, Hutchinson, London, 1949.
• Sellars, W., “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind,” in Minnesota Studies in The Philosophy of Science, Vol. I: The Foundations of Science and the Concepts of Psychology and Psychoanalysis, Feigl, H. and Scriven, M., (eds) Minnesota University Press, Minneapolis, 1956.
• Sellars, W., “Phenomenalism,” in his Science, Perception and Reality, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1963.
• Sellars, W., “Some Reflections on Perceptual Consciousness,” in Selected studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy, Bruzina, R., and Wishire, B., (eds) Nijhoff, The Hague, pp. 169-185, 1977.
• Sellars, W., “Sensa or Sensings: Reflections on the Ontology of Perception,” Philosophical Studies, 41, pp. 83-111, 1982.
• Shaughnessy, B., The Will, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1980.
• Shaughnessy, B., Consciousness and the World, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 2000.
• Smith, D., The Problem of Perception, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2002.
• Snowdon, P., “Perception, Vision, and Causation” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 81, pp. 175-92, 1980.
• Sprigge, T., Facts Words and Beliefs, Routledge, London, 1970.
• Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
• Tye, M., Consciousness, Color and Content, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2000.
• Urmson, J. O., Philosophical Analysis, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1956.
• Valberg, J., The Puzzle of Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1992.
• Williams, M., Unnatural Doubts, Princeton University Press, Princeton, 1996.
• Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical Investigations, Blackwell, Oxford, 1953.

b. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

• Crane, T., (ed.), The Contents of Experience, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1992.
• Dancy, J., (ed.), Perceptual Knowledge, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1988.
• Hirst, R. J., (ed.), Perception and the External World, Macmillan, New York, 1965.
• Schwartz, R., (ed.), Perception, Blackwell, Oxford, 2004.
• Swartz, R. J., (ed.), Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, Anchor, New York, 1965.
• Warnock, G. J., (ed.), The Philosophy of Perception, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1967.

Author Information

Paul Coates
Email: P.Coates@herts.ac.uk
University of Hertfordshire
United Kingdom