Benedict De Spinoza (1632—1677)

Benedict de Spinoza  was among the most important of the post-Cartesian philosophers who flourished in the second half of the 17th century. He made significant contributions in virtually every area of philosophy, and his writings reveal the influence of such divergent sources as Stoicism, Jewish Rationalism, Machiavelli, Hobbes, Descartes, and a variety of heterodox religious thinkers of his day. For this reason he is difficult to categorize, though he is usually counted, along with Descartes and Leibniz, as one of the three major Rationalists. Given Spinoza’s devaluation of sense perception as a means of acquiring knowledge, his description of a purely intellectual form of cognition, and his idealization of geometry as a model for philosophy, this categorization is fair. But it should not blind us to the eclecticism of his pursuits, nor to the striking originality of his thought.

Among philosophers, Spinoza is best known for his Ethics, a monumental work that presents an ethical vision unfolding out of a monistic metaphysics in which God and Nature are identified. God is no longer the transcendent creator of the universe who rules it via providence, but Nature itself, understood as an infinite, necessary, and fully deterministic system of which humans are a part. Humans find happiness only through a rational understanding of this system and their place within it. On account of this and the many other provocative positions he advocates, Spinoza has remained an enormously controversial figure. For many, he is the harbinger of enlightened modernity who calls us to live by the guidance of reason. For others, he is the enemy of the traditions that sustain us and the denier of what is noble within us. After a review of Spinoza’s life and works, this article examines the main themes of his philosophy, primarily as they are set forth in the Ethics.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works
2. Geometric Method and the Ethics
3. Metaphysics
   1. Substance Monism
      1. Definitions
      2. Preliminary Propositions
      3. Substance Monism Demonstrated
   2. The Modal System
      1. Natura naturans and Natura naturata
      2. Two Types of Mode
      3. Causal Determinism
      4. Causal Parallelism
4. Mind and Cognition
   1. The Mind as the Idea of the Body
   2. Imagination
      1. Sense Perception
   3. Inadequate Ideas
   4. Adequate Ideas
   5. Three Kinds of Knowledge
5. Psychology
   1. Rejection of Free-Will
   2. The Conatus Principle
   3. The Affects
   4. Bondage
6. Ethics
   1. Freedom from the Passions
   2. Conatus and the Guidance of Reason
   3. Knowledge of God as the Highest Good
   4. Intellectual Love of God and Human Blessedness
   5. Eternity of the Mind
   6. Conclusion
7. References and Further Reading
   1. Texts and Translations of Spinoza
   2. General Studies Suitable as Introductions
   3. More Advanced and Specialized Studies
   4. Collected Essays on Spinoza

1. Life and Works

Spinoza came into the world a Jew. Born in 1632, he was the son of Marrano parents. They had immigrated to Amsterdam from Portugal in order to escape the Inquisition that had spread across the Iberian Peninsula and live in the relatively tolerant atmosphere of Holland. Spinoza’s father, Michael, was a successful merchant and a respected member of the community. His mother, Hanna, the second of Michael’s three wives, died in 1638, just before Spinoza was to turn six.

The young Spinoza, given the name Baruch, was educated in his congregation’s academy, the Talmud Torah school. There he received the kind of education that the community deemed necessary to constitute one as an educated Jew. This largely consisted of religious study , including instruction in Hebrew, liturgy, Torah, prophetic writings, and rabbinical commentaries. Although Spinoza no doubt excelled in these, he did not move on to the higher levels of study which focused on the Talmud and were typically undertaken by those preparing for the rabbinate. Whether by desire or by necessity, Spinoza left the school in order to work in his father’s business, which he eventually took over with his half-brother, Gabriel.

The Jewish community in Amsterdam was by no means a closed one , but Spinoza’s commercial activities put him in touch with more diverse currents of thought than those to which he had hitherto been exposed. Most significantly, he came into contact with so-called ‘free-thinking’ Protestants – dissenters from the dominant Calvinism – who maintained a lively interest in a wide range of theological issues, as well as in the latest developments in philosophy and science. This naturally included the work of Descartes, which was regarded by many in Holland to be the most promising of several alternatives to scholasticism that had emerged in recent decades. In order to discuss their interests, these free-thinkers organized themselves into small groups, they called colleges, which met on a regular basis. Spinoza may have attended such meetings as early as the first half of the 1650’s, and it is most likely here that he received his first exposure to Cartesian thought.

This is not to say that Spinoza ceased to mine the resources of his own tradition – he became steeped, for example, in the writings of such philosophically important figures as Maimonides and Gersonides – but his intellectual horizons were expanding and he was experiencing a restlessness that drove him to look further afield. It was at this time that he placed himself under the tutelage of an ex-Jesuit, Franciscus Van den Enden, who had recently set up a Latin school in Amsterdam. Van den Enden turned out to be the perfect teacher for Spinoza. In addition to having an excellent reputation as a Latinist, he was a medical doctor who kept abreast of all that was new in the sciences. He was also notorious for his allegedly irreligious cast of mind, and he was a passionate advocate of democratic political ideals. It is safe to say that Spinoza’s studies with Van den Enden included more than lessons on how to decline nouns.

Spinoza’s intellectual reorientation, however, came at a cost. His increasingly unorthodox views and, perhaps, laxity in his observance of the Jewish law strained his relations with the community. Tensions became so great that, in 1656, the elders of the synagogue undertook proceedings to excommunicate him. Without providing details, the writ of excommunication accuses him of ‘abominable heresies’ and ‘monstrous deeds’. It then levels a series of curses against him and prohibits others from communicating with him, doing business with him, reading anything he might write, or even coming into close proximity with him. Spinoza may still have been a Jew, but he was now an outcast.

Little is known about Spinoza’s activities in the years immediately following his excommunication. He continued his studies with Van den Enden and occasionally took up residence in his teacher’s home. As it was now impossible for him to carry on in commerce, it was most likely at this time that he took up lens grinding as an occupation. There is also evidence that he traveled periodically to Leiden to study at the university. There he would have received formal instruction in Cartesian philosophy and become familiar with the work of prominent Dutch Cartesians. In 1661, he settled near Leiden, in the town of Rijnsburg.

It was during this same period, in the late 1650’s, that Spinoza embarked upon his literary career. His first work, the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, is an attempt to formulate a philosophical method that would allow the mind to form the clear and distinct ideas that are necessary for its perfection. It contains, in addition, reflection upon the various kinds of knowledge, an extended treatment of definition, and a lengthy analysis of the nature and causes of doubt. For reasons that are unknown, the Treatise was left unfinished, though it appears that Spinoza always intended to complete it. Shortly thereafter, while in Rijnsburg, Spinoza set to work on his Short Treatise on God, Man, and His Well-Being. This work, circulated privately among friends, foreshadows many of the themes of his mature work, the Ethics. Most notably, it contains an unambiguous statement of the most famous of Spinoza’s theses – the identity of God and Nature.

Spinoza’s stay in Rijnsburg was brief. In 1663 he moved to the town of Voorburg, not far from The Hague, where he settled into a quiet, but busy, life. At the behest of friends, he immediately set about preparing for publication a set of lessons that he had given to a student in Leiden on Descartes’s Principles of Philosophy. The result was the only work that he was to publish under his own name, now Latinized to Benedict: René Descartes’s Principles of Philosophy, Parts I and II, Demonstrated According to the Geometric Method by Benedict de Spinoza of Amsterdam. As a condition of publication, Spinoza had his friend, Lodewijk Meyer, write a preface to the work, warning the reader that his aim was exposition only and that he did not endorse all of Descartes’s conclusions. He also appended a short piece, entitled Metaphysical Thoughts, in which he sketched some of his own views. Despite his admiration for Descartes, Spinoza did not want to be seen as a Cartesian.

Spinoza’s work on Descartes shows him to have been interested from early on in the use of geometric method in philosophy. In addition to putting parts of the Principles into geometric form, he began experimenting with geometric demonstrations of material taken from his own Short Treatise. It was out of this experimentation that the idea arose for a fully geometric presentation of his thought. He began work on this sometime in the early 1660’s, and by 1665 substantial portions of what was to become the Ethics were circulating in draft form among his friends back in Amsterdam. Though he was well into the project by then, the political and religious climate of the day made Spinoza hesitant to complete it . He chose to exercise caution and suspended work on it, turning instead to a book that would prepare an audience receptive to the Ethics. This was the Theological-Political Treatise, which he completed and published anonymously in 1670.

Spinoza’s aim in the Theological-Political Treatise was to argue that the stability and security of society is not undermined but, rather, enhanced by freedom of thought, meaning primarily the freedom to philosophize. As is clear from the text, he considered the primary threat to this freedom emanated from the clergy, whom he accused of playing upon the fears and superstitions of people in order to maintain power. His solution was to divest the clergy of all political power, even to the point of placing authority over the practice of religion in the hands of the sovereign. The sovereign, Spinoza argued, should extend broad liberties within this domain, requiring adherence to no more than a minimal creed that was neutral with respect to competing sects and the meaning of which was open to a variety of interpretations. This, he hoped, would allow philosophers the freedom to do their work unencumbered by the constraints of sectarianism.

As was to be expected, the Theological-Political Treatise was met with a firestorm of criticism. It was condemned as a work of evil, and its author was accused of having nefarious intentions in writing it. Even some of Spinoza’s closest friends were deeply unsettled by it. Though he had assiduously tried to avoid it, Spinoza found himself embroiled in heated religious controversy and saddled with a reputation for atheism, something he greatly resented.

Spinoza’s last move, in 1670, was to The Hague, where he was to live out his remaining years. Besides having to deal with fallout from his Theological-Political Treatise, he witnessed a political revolution that culminated in the murder of the Grand Pensionary of Holland, Jan De Witt, along with his brother, Cornelius, by an angry mob of Orangist-Calvinists. Spinoza admired De Witt for his liberal policies and was horrified at the murder. With the ascent of the Orangist-Calvinist faction, he felt his own situation to be tenuous.

Despite these distractions, Spinoza pressed on. He undertook new projects, including the writing of a Hebrew grammar, and he turned back to work on the Ethics. Given the hostility with which the Theological-Political Treatise was met and the realities of the new political landscape, he must have done so with a deep sense of pessimism about its chances for success. By 1675 it was complete. As he perceived his enemies to have grown in influence and opportunity, however, Spinoza decided against publishing it. Public viewing of the definitive statement of his philosophy would have to wait until after his death.

By this time Spinoza was in a state of failing health. Weakened by a respiratory illness, he devoted the last year of his life to writing a work of political philosophy, his Political Treatise. Though left unfinished at his death, Spinoza’s intention was to show how governments of all types could be improved and to argue for the superiority of democracy over other forms of political organization. Following the lead of Machiavelli and Hobbes, his argument was to be non-utopian, based on a realistic assessment of human nature drawn from the psychological theory set forth in the Ethics. In the part he did finish, Spinoza showed himself to be an astute analyst of diverse constitutional forms and an original thinker among liberal social contract theorists.

Spinoza died peacefully in his rented room in The Hague in 1677. He left no will, but the manuscripts of his unpublished works—the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, the Ethics, the Hebrew Grammar, and the Political Treatise along with his correspondence—were found in in his desk. These were immediately shipped to Amsterdam for publication, and in short order they appeared in print as B.D.S. Opus Posthuma. But even in death Spinoza could not escape controversy; in 1678, these works were banned throughout Holland.

2. Geometric Method and the Ethics

Upon opening Spinoza’s masterpiece, the Ethics, one is immediately struck by its form. It is written in the style of a geometrical treatise, much like Euclid’s Elements, with each book comprising a set of definitions, axioms, propositions, scholia, and other features that make up the formal apparatus of geometry. One wonders why Spinoza would have employed this mode of presentation. The effort it required must have been enormous, and the result is a work that only the most dedicated of readers can make their way through.

Some of this is explained by the fact that the seventeenth century was a time in which geometry was enjoying a resurgence of interest and was held in extraordinarily high esteem, especially within the intellectual circles in which Spinoza moved. We may add to this the fact that Spinoza, though not a Cartesian, was an avid student of Descartes’s works. As is well known, Descartes was the leading advocate of the use of geometric method within philosophy, and his Meditations was written more geometrico, in the geometrical style. In this respect the Ethics can be said to be Cartesian in inspiration.

While this characterization is true, it needs qualification. The Meditations and the Ethics are very different works, not just in substance, but also in style. In order to understand this difference one must take into account the distinction between two types of geometrical method, the analytic and the synthetic. Descartes explains this distinction as follows:

Analysis shows the true way by means of which the thing in question was discovered methodically and as it were a priori, so that if the reader is willing to follow it and give sufficient attention to all points, he will make the thing his own and understand it just as perfectly as if he had discovered it for himself. . . . . Synthesis, by contrast, employs a directly opposite method where the search is, as it were, a posteriori . . . . It demonstrates the conclusion clearly and employs a long series of definitions, postulates, axioms, theorems and problems, so that if anyone denies one of the conclusions it can be shown at once that it is contained in what has gone before, and hence the reader, however argumentative or stubborn he may be, is compelled to give his assent. (CSM II,110-111)

The analytic method is the way of discovery. Its aim is to lead the mind to the apprehension of primary truths that can serve as the foundation of a discipline. The synthetic method is the way of invention. Its aim is to build up from a set of primary truths a system of results, each of which is fully established on the basis of what has come before. As the Meditations is a work whose explicit aim is to establish the foundations of scientific knowledge, it is appropriate that it employs the analytic method. The Ethics, however, has another aim, one for which the synthetic method is appropriate.

As its title indicates, the Ethics is a work of ethical philosophy. Its ultimate aim is to aid us in the attainment of happiness, which is to be found in the intellectual love of God. This love, according to Spinoza, arises out of the knowledge that we gain of the divine essence insofar as we see how the essences of singular things follow of necessity from it. In view of this, it is easy to see why Spinoza favored the synthetic method. Beginning with propositions concerning God, he was able to employ it to show how all other things can be derived from God. In grasping the order of propositions as they are demonstrated in the Ethics, we thus attain a kind of knowledge that approximates the knowledge that underwrites human happiness. We are, as it were, put on the road towards happiness. Of the two methods it is only the synthetic method that is suitable for this purpose.

3. Metaphysics

Although the Ethics is not principally a work of metaphysics, the system it lays out stands as one of the great monuments in the tradition of grand metaphysical speculation. What is perhaps most noteworthy about this system is that it is a species of monism – the doctrine that all of reality is in some significant sense one. In Spinoza’s case, this is exemplified by the claim that there is one and only one substance. This substance he identifies as God. While monism has had its defenders in the west, they have been few and far between. Spinoza is arguably the greatest among them.

a. Substance Monism

Spinoza builds his case for substance monism in a tightly reasoned argument that culminates in IP14. We may best follow the course of this argument by taking it in three parts. First, we examine four definitions that play a crucial role in the argument. Second, we look at two propositions to which the demonstration of IP14 appeals. And third, we turn to the demonstration of IP14 itself.

i. Definitions

Among the eight definitions that open Book One of the Ethics, the following four are most important to the argument for substance monism:

ID3: By substance I understand what is in itself and is conceived through itself, that is, that whose concept does not require the concept of another thing, from which it must be formed.

This definition has two components. First, a substance is what exists in itself. This is to say that it is an ultimate metaphysical subject. While other things may exist as features of a substance, substance does not exist as a feature of anything else. Second, a substance is what is conceived through itself. This is to say that the idea of a substance does not involve the idea of any other thing. Substances are both ontologically and conceptually independent.

ID4: By attribute I understand what the intellect perceives of a substance, as constituting its essence.

An attribute is not just any property of a substance – it is its very essence. So close is the association of an attribute and the substance of which it is an attribute that Spinoza denies that there is a real distinction between them.

ID5: By mode I understand the affections of a substance, or that which is in another through which it is also conceived.

A mode is what exists in another and is conceived through another. Specifically, it exists as a modification or an affection of a substance and cannot be conceived apart from it. In contrast to substances, modes are ontologically and conceptually dependent.

ID6: By God I understand a being absolutely infinite, that is, a substance consisting of an infinity of attributes, of which each one expresses an eternal and infinite essence.

God is an infinite substance. By this Spinoza means both that the number of God’s attributes is unlimited and that there is no attribute that God does not possess. As we make our way through the Ethics, we learn that only two of these attributes can be known by the human mind. These are thought and extension.

ii. Preliminary Propositions

Spinoza moves from these definitions to demonstrate a series of propositions concerning substance in general and God in particular on the basis of which he will demonstrate that God is the one and only substance. The following two propositions are landmarks in the overall argument and are explicitly invoked in the demonstration of IP14:

IP5: In Nature there cannot be two or more substances of the same nature or attribute.

In support of this proposition, Spinoza argues that if two or more substances were to exist they would be differentiated either by a difference in modes or by a difference in attributes. However, they could not be differentiated by a difference in modes, for substances are prior in nature to their modes. Thus, they would have to be differentiated by a difference in attributes. Controversially, Spinoza takes this to entail that no two substances can have exactly the same set of attributes, nor can they have a common attribute. Substances must be entirely dissimilar to one another.

IP11: God, or a substance consisting of infinite attributes, each of which expresses eternal and infinite essence, necessarily exists.

In support of this proposition, Spinoza offers a variant of the so-called Ontological Argument. The basic consideration upon which this variant rests is that it pertains to the nature of substance to exist. Spinoza establishes this earlier, in IP7, by appealing to the fact that substances, being entirely dissimilar to one another, cannot produce one another. Since nothing else can produce a substance, substances must be self-caused, which is to say that it pertains to the nature of substance to exist. To imagine that God does not exist is thus absurd. As a substance consisting of infinite attributes, it pertains to the divine nature to exist.

iii. Substance Monism Demonstrated

With these propositions in place, Spinoza has everything he needs to demonstrate that there is one and only one substance and that this substance is God:

IP14: Except God, no substance can be or be conceived.

The demonstration of this proposition is exceedingly simple. God exists (by IP11). Since God possesses every attribute (by ID6), if any substance other than God were to exist, it would possess an attribute in common with God. But, since there cannot be two or more substances with a common attribute (by IP5), there can be no substance other than God. God is the one and only substance.

The implications of this proposition are startling, and Spinoza can be seen to be working them out through the remainder of the Ethics. Most obviously, this proposition marks a break with the substance pluralism advocated by the majority of philosophers in the west. Even Descartes, from whom Spinoza learned much in the area of metaphysics, posited a plurality of mental and physical substances, along with God, whom he regarded as the paradigm of a substance. More importantly, it signals a rejection of classical theism, the idea that God is the creator of the universe who remains ontologically distinct from it and governs it according to his sovereign will. Spinoza has nothing but scorn for this idea and dismisses it as a product of the imagination. How it is that he reconceptualizes the relation between God, the infinite substance, and the order of finite things, becomes clear only as we turn to his account of the modal system.

b. The Modal System

In line with his rejection of classical theism, Spinoza famously identifies God with Nature. Nature is no longer seen as a power that is distinct from and subordinate to God, but as a power that is one and the same with divine power. Spinoza’s phrase ‘Deus sive Natura’ (‘God or Nature’) captures this identification and is justly celebrated as a succinct expression of his metaphysics. In isolation, however, the phrase is relatively uninformative. It tells us nothing about how Spinoza, having rejected the creator/creation relation posited by the classical model, conceives of the relation between God and the system of modes.

i. Natura naturans and Natura naturata

To fill out his thoughts on this matter, Spinoza distinguishes between Nature taken in its active or productive aspect, which he identifies with God or the divine attributes, and Nature taken in its derivative or produced aspect, which he identifies with the system of modes. The former he calls Natura naturans(literally: Nature naturing) and the latter he calls Natura naturata (literally: Natura natured). Spinoza’s use of these formulas is revealing in two respects. First, his double employment of ‘Natura‘ signals the ontological unity that exists between God and the system of modes. Each mode within the system is a modification of nothing other than the very substance that is God. Second, his employment of the active ‘naturans‘ in the first and the passive ‘naturata‘ in the second signals a causal relation between God and the modal system. God is not merely the subject of modes; he is an active power that produces and sustains them.

In view of the ontological unity that exists between God and the modal system, Spinoza is careful to specify that the divine causality is immanent rather that transitive. What this means is that God’s causal activity does not pass outside of the divine substance to produce external effects, as it would if God were a creator in the traditional sense. Rather, it remains wholly within the divine substance to produce the multitude of modes that constitute the modal system. Spinoza likens this to the way in which the nature of a triangle is productive of its own essential properties: “From God’s supreme power, or infinite nature, infinitely many things in infinitely many modes, that is, all things, have necessarily flowed, or always follow, by the same necessity and in the same way as from the nature of a triangle it follows, from eternity and to eternity, that its three angles are equal to two right angles” (IP17S1). The entire modal system, Natura naturata, follows immanently from the divine nature, Natura naturans.

ii. Two Types of Mode

Into this relatively simple picture, Spinoza introduces a complication. There are, he says, two types of mode. The first consists in what he calls infinite and eternal modes. These are pervasive features of the universe, each of which follows from the divine nature insofar as it follows from the absolute nature of one or another of God’s attributes. Examples include motion and rest under the attribute of extension and infinite intellect under the attribute of thought. The second consists in what may be called finite and temporal modes, which are simply the singular things that populate the universe. Modes of this type follow from the divine nature as well, but do so only as each follows from one or another of God’s attributes insofar as it is modified by a modification that is itself finite and temporal. Examples include individual bodies under the attribute of extension and individual ideas under the attribute of thought.

Unfortunately, Spinoza does little to explain either what these infinite and eternal modes are or what relation they have to finite and temporal modes. Taking their cue from a statement in the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect that the laws of nature are embedded in the infinite and eternal modes, many commentators have suggested that Spinoza thought of these modes as governing the manner in which finite modes affect one another. For example, if laws of impact are somehow embedded in the infinite and eternal mode motion and rest, then the outcome of any particular collision will be determined by that mode together with the relevant properties (speed, direction, size, etc) of the bodies involved. If this is correct, then Spinoza envisions every finite mode to be fully determined by intersecting lines of causality: a horizontal line that stretches back through the series of antecedent finite modes and a vertical line that moves up through the series of infinite modes and terminates in one or another of the attributes of God.

iii. Causal Determinism

However it may be that Spinoza ultimately conceives of the relation between infinite and finite modes, he is clear about one thing – the system of modes is an entirely deterministic system in which everything is fully determined to be and to act:

IP29: In nature there is nothing contingent, but all things have been determined from the necessity of the divine nature to exist and produce an effect in a certain way.

Spinoza reminds us that God’s existence is necessary. It pertains to the very nature of substance to exist. Furthermore, since each and every mode follows from the necessity of the divine nature, either from the absolute nature of one or another of God’s attributes, as is the case with the infinite and eternal modes, or from one or another of God’s attributes insofar as it is modified by a modification that is finite, as is the case with the finite modes, they are all necessary as well. Since there is nothing other than the divine substance and its modes, there is nothing that is contingent. Any appearance of contingency is the result of a defect in knowledge, either of God or of the order of causes. Accordingly, Spinoza makes it central to his theory of knowledge that to know a thing adequately is to know it in its necessity, as it has been fully determined by its causes.

iv. Causal Parallelism

An obvious question to ask at this point is whether it is possible for finite modes falling under one attribute to act upon and determine finite modes falling under another attribute. Spinoza’s answer is an unambiguous no. Causal relations exist only among modes falling under the same attribute. His explanation for this may be traced back to an axiom set forth at the beginning of Book One:

IA4: The knowledge of an effect depends on, and involves, the knowledge of its cause.

Given this axiom, if a finite mode falling under one attribute were to have God as its cause insofar as he is considered under a different attribute, i.e., if it were to be caused by a finite mode falling under a different attribute, then the knowledge of that mode would involve the knowledge of that other attribute. Since it does not, that mode cannot have God as its cause insofar as he is considered under some other attribute. In other words, it cannot be caused by a finite mode falling under some other attribute.

When applied to modes falling under those attributes of which we have knowledge – thought and extension – this has an enormously important consequence. There can be no causal interaction between ideas and bodies. This does not mean that ideas and bodies are unrelated to one another. Indeed, it is one of the best-known theses in the Ethics that the lines of causation that run among them are strictly parallel:

IIP7: The order and connection of ideas is the same as the order and connection of things.

In the demonstration of this proposition Spinoza says that it is a consequence of IA4 and leaves it at that. Nevertheless, it is apparent that this proposition has deep foundations in his substance monism. As thought and extension are not attributes of distinct substances, so ideas and bodies are not modes of distinct substances. They are “one and the same thing, but expressed two ways” (IIP7S). If ideas and bodies are one and the same thing, however, their order and connection must be the same. The doctrine of substance monism in this way insures that ideas and bodies, though causally independent, are causally parallel.

4. Mind and Cognition

It is at this point that Spinoza’s metaphysics touches upon his theory of mind and yields some of its most profound consequences. Most obviously, substance monism prohibits him from affirming the kind of dualism that Descartes affirmed, one in which mind and body are conceived as distinct substances. What is more, his contention that modes falling under different attributes have no causal interaction but are causally parallel to one another prohibits him from affirming that mind and body interact. Because he takes seriously the reality of the mental while rejecting dualism and eliminating interaction, Spinoza’s views on the mind are generally given a sympathetic hearing in a way that Descartes’s views are not.

a. The Mind as the Idea of the Body

To understand Spinoza’s account of the mind we must begin with IIP7. This proposition, together with its scholium, commits him to the thesis that for each finite mode of extension there exists a finite mode of thought that corresponds to it and from which it is not really distinct. More elaborately, it commits him to the thesis that (1) for each simple body there exists a simple idea that corresponds to it and from which it is not really distinct and (2) for each composite body there exists a composite idea that corresponds to it and from which it is not really distinct, composed, as it were, of ideas corresponding to each of the bodies of which the composite body is composed. Spinoza counts all of these ideas, whether simple or composite, as minds. In this respect he does not consider the human mind to be unique. It is simply the idea that corresponds to the human body.

In taking this position, Spinoza does not mean to imply that all minds are alike. As minds are expressions of the bodies to which they correspond in the domain of thought, some have abilities that others do not. Simply put, the greater the capacity of a body for acting and being acted upon, the greater the capacity of the mind that corresponds to it for perception. Spinoza elaborates:

[I]n proportion as a body is more capable than others of doing many things at once, or being acted on in many ways at once, so its mind is more capable than others of perceiving many things at once. And in proportion as the actions of a body depend more on itself alone, and as other bodies concur with it less in acting, so its mind is more capable of understanding distinctly. And from these [truths] we know the excellence of one mind over the others. (IIP13S)

Herein lies the explanation of the excellence of the human mind. The human body, as a highly complex composite of many simple bodies, is able to act and be acted upon in myriad ways that other bodies cannot. The human mind, as an expression of that body in the domain of thought, mirrors the body in being a highly complex composite of many simple ideas and is thus possessed of perceptual capacities exceeding those of other, non-human minds. Only a mind that corresponds to a body of complexity comparable to that of the human body can have perceptual abilities comparable to those of the human mind.

b. Imagination

A perceptual ability that is of particular interest to Spinoza is imagination. This he takes to be a general capacity of representing external bodies as present, whether they are actually present or not. Imagination thus includes more than the capacity to form those mental constructs that we normally consider to be imaginative. It includes memory and sense perception as well. Since it is clearly impossible to get around in the world without this, Spinoza concedes that it is “in this way [that] I know almost all the things that are useful in life” (TIE 22).

That being said, Spinoza consistently opposes imagination to intellect and views it as providing no more than confused perception. To use his preferred terminology, the ideas of the imagination are inadequate. They may be essential for getting around in the world, but they give us a distorted and incomplete picture of the things in it. To understand why, it is useful to begin with sense perception. This is the most important form of imaginative perception, and it is from this form that all others derive.

i. Sense Perception

On Spinoza’s account, sense perception has its origin in the action of an external body upon one or another of the sensory organs of one’s own body. From this there arises a complex series of changes in what amounts to the body’s nervous system. As the mind is the idea of the body, it will represent these changes. This, Spinoza contends, is what constitutes sense perception.

In order to explain how this act of representation yields perception of an external body, Spinoza appeals to the fact that the changed state of one’s body is a function both of the nature of one’s body and the nature of the external body that caused that state. Because of this, the mind’s representation of that state will express something more than the nature of one’s own body. It will express the nature of the external body as well:

IIP16: The idea of any mode in which the human body is affected by external bodies must involve the nature of the human body and at the same time the nature of the external body.

It is this feature of the mind’s act of representation – that it expresses the nature of an external body – that explains how such an act constitutes sense perception.

c. Inadequate Ideas

In view of this it is not difficult to see why Spinoza judges sense perception to be inadequate. Grounded as it is in the mind’s representation of the state of one’s own body rather than in the direct representation of external bodies, sense perception is indirect. Since this goes for all imaginative ideas, the problem with them all is the same:

IIP16C2: It follows, second, that the ideas which we have of external bodies indicate the condition of our own body more than the nature of the external bodies.

It is because of this that Spinoza refers to the ideas of the imagination as confused. The vision they give of external bodies is unavoidably colored, so to speak, by the lens of one’s own body.

Confusion, however, is just one aspect of the inadequacy of imaginative ideas. Such ideas are also mutilated. The reason for this lies in IA4, which states that the knowledge of an effect depends upon and involves the knowledge of its causes. This is a condition that imaginative ideas can never satisfy. The mind may contain the idea of an external body, but it cannot contain ideas of all of the causes of that body. These, being infinite, fall outside of its scope and are fully contained only in God’s infinite intellect. God’s ideas of bodies may be adequate, but ours are not. They are cut off from those ideas that are necessary in order to render them adequate.

d. Adequate Ideas

Although imaginative ideas of external bodies are the most important examples of inadequate ideas, they are not the only examples. Spinoza goes on to show that the mind’s ideas of the body, its duration, and its parts are all inadequate. So too is the mind’s idea of itself. Even so, he remains optimistic about the possibility of adequate ideas.

This optimism becomes evident as Spinoza shifts his attention from imaginative ideas of singular things to intellectual ideas of common things. These common things are things that are either common to all bodies or common to the human body and certain bodies by which the human body is regularly affected. Spinoza tells us little else about these common things, except to say that they are fully present in the whole and in each of the parts of every body in which they are present. Nevertheless, it is fairly certain that the class of things common to all bodies includes the attribute of extension and the infinite and eternal mode of motion and rest. What is included in the class of things common to the human body and those bodies by which the human body is regularly affected is not so certain. Whatever they turn out to be, however, Spinoza assures us that our ideas of them can only be adequate.

To see why, consider some thing, A, that is common to the human body and some body by which the human body is affected. A, Spinoza contends, will be fully present in the affection that arises in the human body as a result of the action of the external body, just as it is in the two bodies themselves. As a result, the mind, in possessing the idea of that affection, not only will have the idea of A, but its idea will be neither confused nor mutilated. The mind’s idea of A will be adequate.

This result is of utmost importance. Because any idea that follows from an adequate idea is itself adequate, these ideas, appropriately called common notions, can serve as axioms in a deductive system. When working out this system, the mind engages in a fundamentally different kind of cognition than when it engages in any of the various forms of imaginative perception. In all forms of imaginative perception the order of ideas mirrors the order of bodily affections, and this order, depending as it does upon the chance encounters of the body with external bodies, is entirely fortuitous. By contrast, the derivation of adequate ideas from common notions within a deductive system follows a wholly different order. This Spinoza calls the order of reason. The paradigm case is geometry.

e. Three Kinds of Knowledge

With this distinction between adequate and inadequate perception in place, Spinoza introduces a set of further distinctions. He begins with inadequate perception, which he now calls knowledge of the first kind, and divides it into two parts. The first consists of knowledge from random experience (experientia vaga). This is knowledge “from singular things which have been represented to us through the senses in a way which is mutilated, confused, and without order for the intellect”(P40S2). The second consists of knowledge from signs (ex signis), “for example, from the fact that, having heard or read certain words, we recollect things, and form certain ideas of them, like those through which we imagine the things”(P40S2). What links both of these forms of knowledge is that they lack a rational order. It is obvious that knowledge from random experience follows the order of the affections of the human body, but so does knowledge from signs. A Roman who hears the word ‘pomum‘, for instance, will think of an apple, not because there is any rational connection between the word and the object, but only because they have been associated in his or her experience.

When we reach what Spinoza calls the second kind of knowledge, reason (ratio), we have ascended from an inadequate to an adequate perception of things. This type of knowledge is gained “from the fact that we have common notions and adequate ideas of the properties of things” (P40S2). What Spinoza has in mind here is what was just indicated, namely, the formation of adequate ideas of the common properties of things and the movement by way of deductive inference to the formation of adequate ideas of other common properties. Unlike in the case of knowledge of the first kind, this order of ideas is rational.

We might think that in attaining this second kind of knowledge we have attained all that is available to us. However, Spinoza adds a third type, which he regards as superior. He calls this intuitive knowledge (scientia intuitiva) and tells us that it “proceeds from an adequate idea of the formal essence of certain attributes of God to the adequate knowledge of the [formal] essence of things”(P40S2). Unfortunately, Spinoza is once again obscure at a crucial junction, and it is difficult to know what he has in mind here. He seems to be envisioning a type of knowledge that gives insight into the essence of some singular thing together with an understanding of how that essence follows of necessity from the essence of God. Furthermore, the characterization of this kind of knowledge as intuitive indicates that the connection between the individual essence and the essence of God is grasped in a single act of apprehension and is not arrived at by any kind of deductive process. How this is possible is never explained.

Problems of obscurity aside, we can still see something of the ideal at which Spinoza is aiming. Inadequate ideas are incomplete. Through them we perceive things without perceiving the causes that determine them to be, and it is for this reason that we imagine them to be contingent. What Spinoza is offering with the third kind of knowledge is a way of correcting this. It is important to note, however, that he is not proposing that we can have this knowledge with respect to the durational existence of any particular item. As we have already seen, this would require having ideas of all of the temporal causes of a thing, which are infinite. Rather, he is proposing that we can have it with respect to the essence of a singular thing as it follows from the essence of God. To have this kind of knowledge is to understand the thing as necessary rather than contingent. It is, to use Spinoza’s famous phrase, to regard it sub quadam specie aeternitatis, under a certain aspect of eternity.

5. Psychology

One of the most interesting but understudied areas of Spinoza’s thought is his psychology, the centerpiece of which is his theory of the affects. Spinoza, of course, was not the first philosopher to take an interest in the affects. He had only to look to the work of Descartes and Hobbes in the previous generation and to the work of the Stoics before them to find sustained discussions of the topic. His own work shows that he learned much from these thinkers.

Despite his debts, Spinoza expressed deep dissatisfaction with the views of those who had preceded him. His dissatisfaction reflects the naturalistic orientation that he wished to bring to the subject:

Most of those who have written about the affects, and men’s way of living, seem to treat, not of natural things, which follow the common laws of Nature, but of things which are outside Nature. Indeed they seem to conceive man in Nature as a dominion within a dominion. For they believe that man disturbs, rather than follows, the order of Nature, that he has absolute power over his actions, and that he is determined only by himself. (III Preface)

In opposition to what he saw as a tendency on the part of previous philosophers to treat humans as exceptions to the natural order, Spinoza proposes to treat them as subject to the same laws and causal determinants as everything else. What emerges can best be described as a mechanistic theory of the affects.

a. Rejection of Free-Will

In working out this new perspective, the first thing on Spinoza’s agenda is to clear away what he sees as the most pervasive confusion that we as humans have about ourselves. This is the belief in free-will. Spinoza has nothing but scorn for this belief and treats it as a delusion that arises from the fact that the ideas we have of our actions are inadequate. “[M]en believe themselves to be free,” he writes, “because they are conscious of their own actions and are ignorant of the causes by which they are determined” (IIIP2S). If we were to acquire adequate ideas of our actions, since these would carry with them knowledge of their causes, we would immediately see this belief as the delusion that it is.

Spinoza’s position on this matter is quite obviously dictated by the determinism of his metaphysics. The mind, as a finite mode, is fully determined to be and to act by other finite modes. To posit a faculty of will by which it is made autonomous and independent of external causal determinants is to remove it from nature. Spinoza will have none of this. As it is fully part of nature, the mind must be understood according to the same principles that govern all modes.

b. The Conatus Principle

The first and most important of these principles is what has come to be known as the Conatus Principle:

IIIP6: Each thing, as far as it can by its own power, strives to persevere in being.

The correct interpretation of this principle is far from clear, but it appears to posit a kind of existential inertia within modes. Each mode, to the extent of its power, so acts as to resist the destruction or diminution of its being. Spinoza expresses this by saying that each mode has an innate striving (conatus) to persevere in being. This striving is so central to what a mode is that he identifies it as a mode’s very essence:

IIIP7: The striving by which each thing strives to persevere in its being is nothing but the actual essence of the thing.

Though a bit mysterious as to what it means to say that the striving of a mode is its essence, this identification will play a key role in Spinoza’s ethical theory. Among other things, it will provide the basis upon which he can determine what is involved in living by the guidance of reason.

c. The Affects

Spinoza begins his account of the affects with those that result from the action of external causes upon the mind. These are the passive affects, or passions. He identifies three as primary – joy, sadness, and desire – and characterizes all others as involving a combination of one or more of these together with some kind of cognitive state. Love and hate, for example, are joy and sadness coupled with an awareness of their respective causes. Longing, for example, is desire coupled with a memory of the desired object and an awareness of its absence. All remaining passions are characterized in a similar fashion.

Although joy, sadness, and desire are primitive, they are each defined in relation to the mind’s striving for perseverance. Joy is that affect by which the mind passes to a greater perfection, understood as an increased power of striving. Sadness is that affect by which the mind passes to a lesser perfection, understood as a decreased power of striving. And desire is the striving for perseverance itself insofar as the mind is conscious of it. Because all passions are derived from these primary affects, the entire passional life of the mind is thus defined in relation to the striving for perseverance.

This may seem paradoxical. Insofar as the mind strives to persevere in being it would appear to be active rather than passive. This is true, but we must realize that the mind strives both insofar as it has adequate ideas and insofar as it has inadequate ideas. The passions are defined only in relation to the mind’s striving insofar as it has inadequate ideas. In fact, the passions are themselves a species of inadequate ideas. And since all inadequate ideas are caused from without, so too are the passions. It is in this respect that they must be considered to be passive rather than active.

This, however, is not the case with those affects that are defined in relation to the mind’s striving insofar as it has adequate ideas. All such affects, being themselves a species of adequate ideas, are active. Mirroring his analysis of the passions, Spinoza takes two of these as primitive – active joy and active desire – and treats the remainder as derivative. (He does not acknowledge the possibility of an active form of sadness, since the diminishment of the mind’s perfection, which is what is involved in sadness, can only occur through the action of external causes.) In doing so, he posits an element within the affective life that is not only active, but, because it is grounded in the mind’s striving insofar as it has adequate ideas, is fully rational. It is a central concern of Spinoza’s ethical program to maximize this element.

d. Bondage

That Spinoza would wish to maximize the active affects is understandable in light of his characterization of life led under the sway of the passions. Such a life is one in which the individual exercises little effective self-control and is buffeted by external circumstances in ways that are largely random. “The man who is subject to the [passive] affects,” Spinoza writes, “is under the control, not of himself, but of fortune, in whose power he so greatly is that often, though he sees the better for himself, he is still forced to follow the worse” (IV Preface). Life under the sway of the passions is a life of bondage.

Unfortunately, the extent to which we can extricate ourselves from the sway of the passions is limited. There are two reasons for this. The first is that the mind is a mode of limited power, yet it is inserted into an order of nature in which there exists an infinite number of modes whose power surpasses its own. To think that the mind can exist unaffected within this order is to assume, falsely, that it is endowed with infinite power or that nothing in nature acts upon it. The second, which is a specification of the first, is that an affect is not restrained merely because it is opposed by reason. It must be opposed by an affect that is stronger than it. The trouble is that reason often lacks this affective power. This is because the strength of the active affects, which pertain to reason, is a function of the strength of the mind alone, whereas the strength of the passive affects, the passions, is a function of the strength of their external causes, which in many cases is greater. In such cases reason is unable to overrule passion and is impotent as a guide. “With this,” Spinoza concludes, “I have shown the cause why men are moved more by opinion than by true reason, and why the true knowledge of good and evil arouses disturbances of the mind, and often yields to lust of every kind” (IV17S). Such is the life of bondage.

6. Ethics

It is from this rather pessimistic diagnosis of the human condition that Spinoza’s ethical theory takes off. In view of this, it is not at all surprising that his ethics is largely one of liberation, a liberation that is directly tied to the cultivation of reason. In this respect, Spinoza’s ethical orientation is much more akin to that of the ancients than to that of his fellow moderns. Like the ancients, he sought not so much to analyze the nature and source of moral duty as to describe the ideal human life. This is the life that is lived by the so-called ‘free-man’. It is a life of one who lives by the guidance of reason rather than under the sway of the passions.

a. Freedom from the Passions

In the opening propositions of Book Five, Spinoza lists a number of respects in which the mind, despite its condition of bondage, is able to weaken the hold that the passions have over it. Generally speaking, it is able to do this insofar as it acquires adequate ideas. This, Spinoza tells us, is due to the fact that “the power of the mind is defined by knowledge alone, whereas lack of power, or passion, is judged solely by the privation of knowledge, that is, by that through which ideas are called inadequate” (VP20S). Two examples illustrate this liberating power of adequate ideas.

First, Spinoza claims that the mind is able to form adequate ideas of its affects. It can thus form adequate ideas of the passions, which are themselves inadequate ideas. Since there is no real distinction between an idea and the idea of that idea, those passions of which the mind forms adequate ideas are thereby dissolved.

Second, the effect of a thing upon the mind is lessened to the extent that it is understood to be necessary rather than contingent. We tend, for example, to be saddened less by the loss of a good when we understand that its loss was inevitable. Similarly, we tend to be angered less by another person’s actions when we understand that he or she could not have done otherwise. Since adequate ideas present things as necessary rather than as contingent, the acquisition of such ideas thereby lessens their effect upon the mind.

As these examples illustrate, the mind’s power over the passions is a function of the adequate ideas that it possess. Liberation lies in the acquisition of knowledge, which empowers the mind and renders it less susceptible to external circumstances. In taking this position, Spinoza places himself in a long tradition that stretches back to the Stoics and ultimately to Socrates.

b. Conatus and the Guidance of Reason

Spinoza tells us that the model human life – the life lived by the ‘free-man’ – is one that is lived by the guidance of reason rather than under the sway of the passions. This tells us very little, however, unless we know what it is that reason prescribes. In order to make this determination, Spinoza falls back upon the mind’s striving for perseverance:

Since reason demands nothing contrary to Nature, it demands that everyone love himself, seek his own advantage, what is really useful to him, want what will really lead a man to greater perfection, and absolutely, that everyone should strive to preserve his own being as far as he can. This, indeed, is as necessarily true as that the whole is greater than its part. (IVP18S)

Reason’s prescription is egoistic. We are to act in accordance with our nature. But since our nature is identical to our striving to persevere in being, reason prescribes that we do whatever is to our advantage and seek whatever aids us in our striving. To act this way, Spinoza insists, is to act virtuously.

This does not mean that in living by the guidance of reason we necessarily place ourselves at odds with others. Reason prescribes that individuals seek whatever aids in the striving for perseverance. But since the goods that are necessary in order to persevere in being are attainable only within the context of social life, reason dictates that we act in ways that are conducive to the stability and harmony of society. Spinoza goes so far as to say that in a society in which everyone lives by the guidance of reason, there would be no need of political authority to restrict action. It is only insofar as individuals live under the sway of the passions that they come into conflict with one another and are in need of political authority. Those who live by the guidance of reason understand this and recognize that authority as legitimate.

c. Knowledge of God as the Highest Good

Spinoza’s contention that those who live by the guidance of reason will naturally live in harmony with one another receives some support from his view of the highest good for a human. This is the knowledge of God. Since this knowledge can be possessed equally by all who seek it, it can be sought by all without drawing any into conflict.

To establish that the knowledge of God is the highest good, Spinoza again appeals to the fact that the mind’s striving is its essence. Since what follows from the mind’s essence alone are adequate ideas, this allows him to construe the mind’s striving as a striving for adequate ideas. It is a striving for understanding:

IVP26: What we strive for from reason is nothing but understanding; nor does the mind, insofar as it uses reason, judge anything else useful to itself except what leads to understanding.

From here it is but an easy step to show that the knowledge of God is the mind’s greatest good. As an infinite substance, God is the greatest thing that can be conceived. Moreover, since everything other than God is a mode of God, and since modes can neither be nor be conceived without the substance of which they are modes, nothing else can be or be conceived apart from God. Spinoza concludes:

IVP28: Knowledge of God is the mind’s greatest good: its greatest virtue is to know God.

The knowledge of God is the fulfillment of the mind’s striving to persevere in being.

d. Intellectual Love of God and Human Blessedness

In elaborating this thesis, Spinoza specifies this knowledge as knowledge of the third kind. This is the knowledge that proceeds from the adequate idea of one or another of God’s attributes to the adequate idea of the formal essence of some singular thing that follows from that attribute. When we possess knowledge of the third kind, we possess adequate perception of God’s essence considered not only in itself, but as the immanent causal power of the particular modifications to which it is subject. Knowledge of the first kind, because it is inadequate, and knowledge of the second kind, because it is restricted to the common properties of things, both fail to give us this.

In attaining the third kind of knowledge the mind passes to the highest state of perfection that is available to it. As a result, it experiences active joy to the greatest possible degree. More importantly, since it is by this kind of knowledge that the mind understands God to be the cause of its own perfection, it gives rise to an active love for God as well. This Spinoza refers to as the intellectual love of God. It is the affective correlate to the third kind of knowledge.

The intellectual love of God turns out to have a great many unique properties. Among other things, it is entirely constant, it has no contraries, and it is the very love by which God loves himself. Most significantly, it constitutes the blessedness of the one who possesses it. When such a love dominates one’s affective life, one attains the serenity and freedom from passion that is the mark of wisdom. Spinoza thus writes of the person who has attained this love that he “is hardly troubled in spirit, but being, by a certain eternal necessity, conscious of himself, and of God, and of things, he never ceases to be, but always possess true peace of mind” (VP42S). This is human blessedness.

e. Eternity of the Mind

Spinoza’s comment that a person who has attained the intellectual love of God “never ceases to be” is perplexing to say the least. It signals a commitment to the view that in some fashion or another the mind, or some part of it, survives the death of the body:

VP23: The human mind cannot be absolutely destroyed with the body, but something of it remains which is eternal.

At first sight, this appears to be in violation of Spinoza’s anti-dualist contention that mind and body are one and the same thing conceived under two different attributes. On the basis of this contention, one would expect him to reject the survival of the mind in any fashion. That he asserts it instead has understandably been a source of great controversy among his commentators.

At least some of the problem can be cleared away by taking account of a crucial distinction that Spinoza makes between the existence of the body and its essence. The existence of the body is its actual duration through time. This involves its coming to be, the changes it undergoes within its environment, and its eventual destruction. By contrast, the essence of the body is non-durational. It is grounded in the timeless essence of God, specifically as one among the innumerable particular ways of being extended.

The importance of this distinction lies in the fact that, by appealing to the parallelism doctrine, Spinoza can conclude that there is a corresponding distinction with respect to the mind. There is an aspect of the mind that is the expression of the existence of the body, and there is an aspect of the mind that is the expression of the essence of the body. Spinoza readily concedes that the aspect of the mind that expresses the existence of the body cannot survive the destruction of the body. It is destroyed with the destruction of the body. Such, however, is not the fate of the aspect of the mind that expresses the essence of the body. Like its object, this aspect of the mind is non-durational. Since only what is durational ceases to be, this aspect of the mind is unaffected by the destruction of the body. It is eternal.

Here we must be careful not to misunderstand what Spinoza is saying. In particular, we should not take him to be offering anything approaching a full-blooded doctrine of personal immortality. In fact, he dismisses the belief in personal immortality as arising from confusion: “If we attend to the common opinion of men, we shall see that they are indeed conscious of the eternity of their mind, but that they confuse it with duration, and attribute it to the imagination, or memory, which they believe remains after death” (VP34S). Individuals have some awareness of the eternity of their own minds. But they mistakenly believe that this eternity pertains to the durational aspect of the mind, the imagination. As it is the imagination, inclusive of memory, that constitutes one’s unique identity as a person, the belief in personal immortality is similarly mistaken.

None of this is to say that Spinoza’s doctrine of the eternity of the mind has no relevance to ethics. Although the imagination is not eternal, the intellect is. And since the intellect is constituted by the mind’s store of adequate ideas, the mind is eternal precisely to the extent that it has these ideas. As a consequence, a person whose mind is constituted largely by adequate ideas participates more fully in eternity than a person whose mind is constituted largely by inadequate ideas. So, while Spinoza offers us no hope of personal immortality, we may take consolation in the fact that “death is less harmful to us, the greater the mind’s clear and distinct knowledge, and hence, the more the mind loves God” (VP38S).

f. Conclusion

Spinoza does not pretend that any of this is easy. The acquisition of adequate ideas, especially those by which we attain knowledge of the third kind, is difficult, and we can never completely escape the influence of the passions. Nevertheless, Spinoza holds out to those who make the effort the promise, not of personal immortality, but of participation in eternity within this life. He closes the Ethics with these words:

If the way I have shown to lead to these things now seems very hard, still, it can be found. And of course, what is found so rarely must be hard. For if salvation were at hand, and could be found without great effort, how could nearly everyone neglect it? But all things excellent are as difficult as they are rare. (VP42S)

7. References and Further Reading

All passages from the texts of Spinoza are taken from the translations appearing in The Collected Works of Spinoza. Vol.I. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985). Passages from the Ethics are cited according to Book (I – V), Definition (D), Axiom (A), Proposition (P), Corollary (C), and Scholium (S). (IVP13S) refers to Ethics, Book IV, Proposition 13, Scholium. Passages from the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect are cited according to paragraph number. (TIE 35) refers to Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, paragraph 35.

All passages from the texts of Descartes are taken from the translations appearing in The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. 2 Vols. Edited and translated by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff & Dugald Murdoch (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985). Passages are cited according to volume and page number. (CSM II,23) refers to Cottingham, Stoothoff & Murdoch, Volume II, page 23.

a. Texts and Translations of Spinoza

• Spinoza Opera. 4 Vols. Edited by Carl Gebhart. (Heidelberg: Carl Winter, 1925).
  • Standard critical edition of Spinoza’s writings and correspondence in Latin and Dutch.
• The Collected Works of Spinoza. Vol. I. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. (Princeton University Press, 1985).
  • First of two volumes (the second is not yet complete) in what, when complete, will become the standard translation into English of Spinoza’s writings and correspondence.
• A Spinoza Reader: The Ethics and Other Works. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1994).
  • Useful reader that contains the entire text of the Ethics, as well as substantial selections from the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, the Short Treatise, and theTheological-Political Treatise. Also contains helpful selections from Spinoza’s correspondence.
• Baruch Spinoza: The Complete Works. Edited by Michael L. Morgan and translated by Samuel Shirley. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 2002).
  • Only modern translation into English of Spinoza’s complete works, including his correspondence.

b. General Studies Suitable as Introductions

• Allison, Henry. Benedict de Spinoza: An Introduction. (New Haven: Yale UP, 1987).
• Curley, Edwin. Behind the Geometrical Method. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988).
• Lloyd, Genevieve. Spinoza and the “Ethics”. (London: Routledge, 1996).
• Hampshire, Stuart. Spinoza. (London: Penguin, 1951).
• Steinberg, Diane, On Spinoza. (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 2000).

c. More Advanced and Specialized Studies

• Bennett, Jonathan. A Study of Spinoza’s “Ethics”. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1984).
• De Dijn, Herman. Spinoza: The Way to Wisdom. (West Lafayette, IN: Purdue University Press, 1996).
• Della Rocca, Michael. Representation and the Mind-Body Problem in Spinoza. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996).
• Donagan, Alan. Spinoza. (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1988). Curley, Edwin. Spinoza’s Metaphysics: An Essay in Interpretation. (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1969).
• Delahunty, R.J. Spinoza. (London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1985).
• Lloyd, Genevieve, Part of Nature: Self-Knowledge in Spinoza’s Ethics. (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1994).
• Mark, Thomas Carson. Spinoza’s Theory of Truth. (New York: Columbia University Press, 1972).
• Mason, Richard. The God of Spinoza: A Philosophical Study. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997).
• Nadler, Steven. Spinoza: A Life. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999).
• Nadler, Steven. Spinoza’s Heresy. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001).
• Wolfson, Harry Austryn. The Philosophy of Spinoza. 2 Vols. (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1934).
• Woolhouse, R.S. Descartes, Spinoza, Leibniz: The Concept of Substance in Seventeenth Century Metaphysics. (London: Routledge, 1993).
• Yovel, Yrmiyahu, Spinoza and Other Heretics. Vol.I: The Marrano of Reason; Vol.II: The Adventures of Immanence. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1989).

d. Collected Essays on Spinoza

• Chappell, Vere (ed.). Baruch de Spinoza. (New York: Garland Publishing, 1992).
• Curley, Edwin and Pierre-François Moreau (eds.). Spinoza: Issues and Directions. (Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1990).
• Freeman, Eugene and Maurice Mandelbaum (eds.). Spinoza: Essays in Interpretation. (LaSalle, IL: Open Court, 1975).
• Garrett, Don (ed.). The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996).
• Grene, Marjorie (ed.). Spinoza: A Collection of Critical Essays. (Garden City, NY: Doubleday/Anchor Press, 1973).
• Grene, Marjorie and Debra Nails (eds.). Spinoza and the Sciences. (Dordrecht: Reidel, 1986).
• Kennington, Richard (ed.). The Philosophy of Baruch Spinoza. (Washington DC: Catholic University Press, 1980).
• Lloyd, Genevieve (ed.). Spinoza Critical Assessments, 4 Vols. (London: Routledge, 2001).
• Shanan, Robert and J.I. Biro (eds.). Spinoza: New Perspectives. (Norman, OK: University of Oklahoma Press, 1978).

Author Information

Blake D. Dutton
Email: bdutton@luc.edu
Loyola University Chicago
U. S. A.

Johann Georg Hamann (1730—1788)

Johann Georg Hamann was the philosophically most sophisticated thinker of the German Counter-enlightenment. Born in 1730 in Königsberg in eastern Prussia, Hamann was a contemporary and friendly acquaintance of the philosopher Immanuel Kant, and in many ways Hamann’s career can be seen in parallel to that of his great friend. Like Kant, Hamann attended the University of Königsberg, and in his early life was a devoted partisan of the Enlightenment, the philosophical and literary movement that emphasized the clearing away of outdated prejudice and the application of scientific reason to every area of human life. But during a business trip to London (on behalf of the firm of the Berens family, who also published Kant’s works), Hamann underwent a sort of conversion that involved giving up his commitment to the secular Enlightenment in favor of a more orthodox view of Protestant Christianity. As a consequence, he embarked on a career of trenchant and often scathing criticism of the Enlightenment. This change in world-views coincided with his reading of the British empiricist philosophers George Berkeley and David Hume. Hamann saw the idealism of the former and the skepticism of the latter as constituting a reductio ad absurdum of Enlightenment thought: Scientific reason leads us inevitably either to doubt or to deny the reality of the world around us. Three of Hamann’s intellectual achievements are of particular significance: His writings Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten (Socratic Memorabilia) and Aesthetica in nuce (Aesthetics in a Nutshell), in which he opposed Enlightenment thought with an indirect and ironic mode of discourse emphasizing the importance of aesthetic experience and the role of genius in intuiting nature; his views on language; and his influential criticisms of Kant’s critical thought, expressed in his “Metakritik über den Purismum der Vernunft” and in his commentary, in a letter to Johann Gottfried Herder, on Kant’s essay “What is Enlightenment?”

Table of Contents

1. Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten and Aesthetica in nuce
2. Hamann’s Views on Language
3. “Metacritique” of Kant
4. References and Further Reading
   1. Works in German
   2. Works in English
   3. Works in English that Discuss Hamann

1. Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten and Aesthetica in nuce

Hamann’s rejection of the Enlightenment was greeted with distress by his friends Kant and Berens. Although they hoped that he could be won back to the cause of reason, these hopes were dashed with the publication in 1759 of Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten, and the following year of Aesthetica in nuce. Together these two works offer a world-view that might be described as antirationalist but not irrationalist.

Hamann’s intention in the Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten is to offer a defense of religious faith that renders such faith immune against rational attack while in no way accepting the rationalist’s terms of debate. In order to do this, however, he faces a seemingly insoluble problem: He must undermine the grounds of the Enlightenment view of reason and religion without committing himself to other, opposed positions that are subject to rational criticism and refutation. Several aspects of how he goes about this were very influential in German thought in the 18^th century. First, the work is written under a pseudonym, or rather, not under any name at all: The title page says that the Denkwürdigkeiten were “assembled for the boredom of the public by a lover of boredom,” most likely a reference to the Enlighteners’ desire to educate the public in the name of reason. By distancing himself from the authorship of what was probably his most important work, Hamann makes clear that any arguments offered or positions taken in the book ought to be viewed as moves in a game rather than as expressions of his rational faculty. Second, Hamann makes crucial use of irony, specifically Socratic irony, in his attack on the Enlightenment. “I have,” says Hamann at the beginning of the work, “written about Socrates in a Socratic manner. Analogy was the soul of his syllogisms, and he gave them irony as their body.” Specifically, Hamann holds up Socrates, the philosophers’ secular saint, in order to draw an unfavorable contrast between him and the Enlightenment. Despite his wisdom, Socrates explicitly renounced his claim to know the answers to the questions he asked; rather than taking and defending determinate positions on the issues he was interested in, Socrates engaged his listeners in conversation so as to bring them to realize that they did not know the answers to these questions any more than Socrates did. Similarly, Hamann intends the Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten to show that Berens and Kant are (at least) as far from genuine knowledge as he is. Finally, like all of Hamann’s works, the style of the Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten is intentionally opaque: In contrast to the Enlightenment emphasis on universal truths that transcend the time and place in which they are expressed, Hamann fills his text with oblique allusions to a wide variety of texts in several languages; moves from one point to another with little indication of how the various passages are supposed to hang together; and shifts without warning from careful argumentative analysis to citation of texts to something like oracular declamation. As a result, it is impossible for the reader to forget that the text she is reading is the work of a particular individual writing in a particular time and place, rather than expressing timeless deliverances of reason.

How then does the text of the Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten accomplish the defense of religious faith Hamann desires? The chief contention of the work is that religious faith is neither based on nor subject to reason. Here Hamann relies not so much on Socrates but rather on David Hume, whose skeptical writings had affected him so deeply a few years before. Hume would doubtless have found little to his liking in Hamann’s rejection of the Enlightenment, but Hamann found much in Hume to serve his purposes. Specifically, Hamann adapts Hume’s important claim that “belief… [etc.].” Hume intends this as a way of answering the worst sort of skepticism: If our beliefs are not based on reasoning, then reasoning cannot threaten them, either. Hamann makes use of the fact that in German there is one word, ‘Glaube,’ that corresponds both to ‘belief’ and to ‘faith’ in English. Thus in his hands Hume’s claim is extended to religious faith as well, making it immune from rational criticism. But this is not to be understood as a position taken with debates about the philosophical foundations of religion. Instead, Hamann again makes use of the figure of Socrates. He compares Socrates to someone refusing to join a game of cards: If this person didn’t know how to play, Hamann observes, we might take their refusal as an expression of incapacity, much as we would take an expression of ignorance from an ordinary person as a genuine indication that he lacks knowledge. But in the case of Socrates, who was manifestly a deep thinker and great philosopher, professions of ignorance must be read as refusals to participate in a game in which the other players “break the rules of the game and steal its joy [das Glück desselben stehlen]. Socrates’ ignorance thus became a “thorn in the eyes” of the sophists (here again Kant and Berens are clearly intended) and serve as “testimony” against the “new Athenians” of Hamann’s time, who deified Socrates “in order to be better able to mock the carpenter’s son [Jesus].”

But if Socrates was a great philosopher, as Hamann emphasizes, what can he be said to know? Hamann’s answer to this question is ‘genius.’

What in Homer makes up for the ignorance of artistic rules, that Aristotle thought up after him, and what in Shakespeare makes up for the ignorance or violation of these rules? Genius (Genie) is the unambiguous answer. Socrates could thus well have been ignorant; he had a genius (Genius) on whose knowledge he could rely, and who he feared as his God.Hamann’s use of the notion of genius in the Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten serves as a bridge to his second major work, the Aesthetica in nuce. His target in the Aesthetica is Enlightenment thought as it applies specifically to art and beauty. Aesthetics in the Enlightenment alternated between attempts to reduce art to rules, more specifically rules for the accurate and morally uplifting imitation of nature, and attempts to explain art as a response to the subjective human capacity for feeling and sensation. Hamann emphatically rejects both of these tendencies, along with the devaluation of the aesthetic he seems them as implying. Far from being reducible to rational principles, in his view aesthetic experience is a fundamental and immediate experience of nature, which he encapsulates (both in the Aesthetica and in Sokratische Denkwürdigkeiten) under the term ‘genius.’

The chief philosophical significance of the Aesthetica in nuce is that Hamann here deepens his conception of the connection between artistic genius, nature, and God. Nature, he says, is “a speech through creation to creation.” That is, nature is a text written by God, which, being creatures ourselves, we are able to understand through His grace. But this understanding is of course not a rational one, through concepts and scientific investigation. Rather, in aesthetic experience we grasp nature in a manner that precedes, and indeed forms the basis for, rational thought: “Poetry [Poesie] is the native tongue of the human race, just as gardening is older than agriculture, painting older than writing, chant older than declamation, similes older than conclusions, and barter than trade.” This view has radical consequences for the Enlightenment. Whereas the task of philosophical aesthetics in the early modern period was to incorporate aesthetic experience into the rational worldview, Hamann now argues that we must instead do the former, that is, view reason as one aspect of our aesthetic experience of the world. It is thus pointless to try to formulate rational standards for beauty. Second, giving art priority over reason threatens reason’s claim to be the proper form for representing nature, which is crucial to the central role given in the Enlightenment to natural science. Finally, if reason is subordinated to art rather than the reverse, then in so far as there is a tension between artistic and rational views of the world the value placed on reason in the 18^th-century represents not progress but regress. Hamann’s early writings inspired thinkers such as Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi, who appropriated the skeptical arguments of David Hume to argue that reason is based entirely on faith, and Johann Gottfried Herder, who offered an account of human thought that emphasized the continuous historical development of humanity from its original natural state. More immediately, Hamann’s thought had an enormous impact on the literary movement known as the Sturm und Drang– literally, “storm and stress.” Works of the Sturm und Drang emphasized nature and human passion. Indeed these two themes were closely linked, in that passion was seen as closer to nature. More distantly, Hamann’s thought was instrumental in the rise, around the turn of the century, of the Romantic movement in Germany.

2. Hamann’s Views on Language

From his earliest works onward, language was a central theme in all of Hamann’s writings. Here too his opposition to the Enlightenment was influential not only in his time but also in present-day philosophy and literary theory. Hamann’s account of language can best be understood by contrast with an admittedly too-simple sketch of the sort of view he opposed. Much Enlightenment thought on language was naturalistic, that is, it saw language as a useful tool invented by human beings. The original humans were thinking, rational beings who invented symbols, attaching names things in the world around them for purposes of communication and learning. Thus both reason and the world precede, and are independent of, language. Hamann rejects this view in all its particulars.

Important elements of Hamann’s account of language are already visible in the Aesthetica in nuce, in particular in the claim that the world is “a speech through creation to creation.” Here it is clear that language for Hamann is not something projected onto the world by human reason, but instead is as it were embedded in the things themselves by God the creator. At some points in his writings on language, Hamann maintains the position that language is simultaneously the work of both God and humans, while at other places he seems to lean more toward the view that God alone is the source of language. In any case, he clearly holds the view that neither thought nor reason is possible independently of language. Indeed, since God’s act of creation is in a sense inherently linguistic, he must hold that language precedes, or at least is contemporaneous with reason in particular and thought in general. As we will see, this is an idea that is very important for his critique of the philosophy of Immanuel Kant.

3. “Metacritique” of Kant

In 1781 Hamann’s friend but philosophical opponent Immanuel Kant published his Critique of Pure Reason. Kant’s project in the Critique has two sides. On the one hand, Kant argues that reason is incapable of attaining knowledge of the existence of, for example, God and the immortality of the soul; however, these beliefs are also incapable of being refuted through reason. This much, of course, Hamann could gladly agree with. But Kant also undertakes to defend both reason and the claim of natural science to offer a privileged description of the world. The latter task is accomplished in the Transcendental Deduction of the Categories, in which Kant argues that our experience requires us to understand the natural world as being composed of substances interacting according to necessary causal laws discoverable by natural science. The former task (which is Hamann’s chief target) is accomplished by reinterpreting reason as the ability to set goals for human cognition and moral action. This alarmed Hamann because it put reason in the place of religious faith, along with the tradition and culture he thought essential to human understanding. In response to Kant’s work, which was the most important event in German philosophy in the 18^th century, Hamann penned a short essay entitled “Metakritik über den Purismum der Vernunft” (“Metacritique on the Purism of Reason”). Although the Metacritique was never published in Hamann’s lifetime, he included it in a letter to his friend Johann Gottfried Herder (who was also a student of Kant’s), and Herder passed it on to Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi, thus enabling this small but interesting text to exert what one commentator has called a “subterranean influence” on German thought after Kant.

Hamann’s thesis in the Metacritique is that “language is the center of reason’s misunderstanding with itself.” More specifically, Hamann thinks that Kant’s critical philosophy, while maintaining that everything in the world must submit to rational questioning and appraisal, nevertheless overlooks the crucial fact that all use of reason, including Kant’s reason, depends on language: Kant imagines, he says, that he can simply “invent” a “universal philosophical language,” whereas here and elsewhere Hamann maintains that words have meaning only in relation to the time and place where they are appropriate. Hamann is clearly on to something important here, because the force of Kant’s conclusions in the Critique of Pure Reason requires that we accept his quite substantial body of terminology, such as the distinctions between a priori and a posteriori, and between analytic and synthetic propositions. But, one might ask, why can’t one simply invent terms of art and stipulate their meanings? This is probably, in fact, what Kant saw himself as doing. Hamann answers this question indirectly, by appealing to the empiricists Berkeley and Hume. Both Berkeley and Hume reject the existence of so-called “abstract ideas,” arguing that there is no philosophical justification for referring to anything in the world other than particular sensible things, whereas abstract ideas are things that can exist only in the privacy of human minds. Since Kant himself accepts the quasi-empiricist view that our knowledge is limited to possible experience, Hamann’s point is that Kant cannot justify his own philosophical enterprise unless he can offer a justification for the very language in which the enterprise is couched- a demand that seems impossible for Kant to fulfill.

Quite late in his life, Hamann participated in another intellectual dispute involving Kant, this one centering on the question, “What is enlightenment.” Although Kant was not the first to contribute to this debate, his was the most prominent and influential statement on the question. In his essay, also entitled “What is Enlightenment?,” Kant defines enlightenment as “the departure of human beings from their self-incurred incapacity.” Its slogan, he says, is sapere aude!— Dare to think! Ignorance on this view is a sort of moral failing in human beings who have neglected to exercise their rational faculties to the fullest extent possible. Hamann responded to Kant’s essay not in print, but rather in a letter to a former student of Kant’s, Christian Jacob Kraus. Again, his target is the Enlightenment’s belief that reason rather than culture, tradition, or religious faith, is the proper guide for human life. His response to Kant turns on an important change in Kant’s language: For Kant’s word “incapacity” [Unmündigkeit] he substitutes the word “domination” [Vormundschaft]. Failure to be fully enlightened results, Hamann suggests, not from a failure to think for oneself, but rather from the fact that people are told what to think by people-like Kant– who see themselves as more rational and thus closer to the truth than ordinary mortals. Hamann thus rejects Kant’s view that the incapacity he bemoans is “self-incurred.” Instead, the “enlightened” state replaces one dominant group (say, the aristocracy) with another (“Enlighteners” such as Kant). Here Hamann anticipates, at least in broad strokes, the late 20^th-century suspicion that liberal democracy cannot live up to its own pretensions to universal tolerance, because viewing oneself as a citizen in a liberal democracy requires many of us to subordinate some of our most passionately held beliefs to the demands of citizenship.

Johann Georg Hamann died in 1788.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Works in German

• Samtliche Werke, ed. by Josef Nadler (Vienna: Verlag Herder, 1951).
• Schriften zur Sprache, ed. by Josef Simon (Frankfurt: Suhrkamp Verlag, 1967).
• Sokratische Denkwurdigkeiten/Aesthetica in nuce, ed. by Sven-Aage Jorgenson (Stuttgart: Philipp Reclam Verlag, 1968).
• Hamann and others, Was ist Aufklarung?, ed. by Ehrhard Bahr (Stuttgart: Philipp Reclam Verlag, 1974).

b. Works in English

• Hamann’s Socratic Memorabilia. A Translation and Commentary, trans. and ed. by James C. O’Flaherty (Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins Press, 1967).
• What is Enlightenment? 18^th Century Answers, 20^th Century Questions
• ed. by James B. Schmidt (Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1996).

c. Works in English that Discuss Hamann

• Beiser, Frederick C., The Fate of Reason: German Philosophy from Kant to Fichte (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1987).
• Berlin, Isaiah, The Magus of the North: J. G. Hamann and the Origins of Modern Irrationalism (New York: Farrar Straus and Giroux, 1993).
• Dickson, Gwen G., Johann Georg Hamann’s Relational Metacriticism (Berlin and New York: De Gruyter, 1995).
• Kühn, Manfred, Kant: A Biography (New York : Cambridge University Press, 2001).
• O’ Flaherty, James C., The Quarrel of Reason with Itself: Essays on Hamann, Nietzsche, Lessing, & Michaelis (Rochester, NY: Camden House, 1991).

Author Information

Ted Kinnaman
Email: mailto:tkinnama@gmu.edu
George Mason University
U. S. A.

Søren Kierkegaard (1813—1855)

Søren Kierkegaard is an outsider in the history of philosophy. His peculiar authorship comprises a baffling array of different narrative points of view and disciplinary subject matter, including aesthetic novels, works of psychology and Christian dogmatics, satirical prefaces, philosophical “scraps” and “postscripts,” literary reviews, edifying discourses, Christian polemics, and retrospective self-interpretations. His arsenal of rhetoric includes irony, satire, parody, humor, polemic and a dialectical method of “indirect communication” – all designed to deepen the reader’s subjective passionate engagement with ultimate existential issues. Like his role models Socrates and Christ, Kierkegaard takes how one lives one’s life to be the prime criterion of being in the truth. Kierkegaard’s closest literary and philosophical models are Plato, J.G. Hamann, G.E. Lessing, and his teacher of philosophy at the University of Copenhagen Poul Martin Møller, although Goethe, the German Romantics, Hegel, Kant and the logic of Adolf Trendelenburg are also important influences. His prime theological influence is Martin Luther, although his reactions to his Danish contemporaries N.F.S. Grundtvig and H.L. Martensen are also crucial. In addition to being dubbed “the father of existentialism,” Kierkegaard is best known as a trenchant critic of Hegel and Hegelianism and for his invention or elaboration of a host of philosophical, psychological, literary and theological categories, including: anxiety, despair, melancholy, repetition, inwardness, irony, existential stages, inherited sin, teleological suspension of the ethical, Christian paradox, the absurd, reduplication, universal/exception, sacrifice, love as a duty, seduction, the demonic, and indirect communication.

Table of Contents

1. Life (1813-55)
   1. Father and Son: Inherited Melancholy
   2. Regina Olsen: The Sacrifice of Love
   3. The Master of Irony and the Seductions of Writing
   4. The “Authorship”: From Melancholy to Humor
   5. The “Second Authorship”: Self-Sacrifice, Love, Despair, and the God-Man
   6. The Attack on the Danish People’s Church
2. The “Aesthetic Authorship”
   1. On the Concept of Irony and Either/Or
   2. Fear and Trembling and Repetition
   3. Philosophical Fragments, The Concept of Anxiety, and Prefaces
   4. Stages on Life’s Way and Concluding Unscientific Postscript
3. The Edifying Discourses
   1. Sermons, Deliberations, and Edifying Discourses
   2. Direct and Indirect Communication
   3. That Single Individual, My Reader
4. The “Second Authorship”
   1. Works of Love
   2. Anti-Climacus
   3. The Attack on the Church
5. References and Further Reading

1. Life (1813-55)

a. Father and Son: Inherited Melancholy

Søren Aabye Kierkegaard was born on May 5th 1813 in Copenhagen. He was the seventh and last child of wealthy hosier, Michael Pedersen Kierkegaard and Ane Sørensdatter Lund, a former household servant and distant cousin of Michael Kierkegaard. This was Michael Kierkegaard’s second marriage, which came within a year of his first wife’s death and four months into Ane Lund’s first pregnancy. Michael Kierkegaard was a deeply melancholic man, sternly religious and carried a heavy burden of guilt, which he imposed on his children. Søren Kierkegaard often lamented that he had never had a childhood of carefree spontaneity, but that he had been “born old.” As a starving shepherd boy on the Jutland heath Michael had cursed God. His surname derived from the fact that his family was indentured to the parish priest, who provided a piece of the church (Kirke) farm (Gaard) for the family’s use. The name Kirkegaard (in older spelling Kierkegaard) more commonly means ‘churchyard’ or ‘cemetery.’ A sense of doom and death seemed to hover over Michael Kierkegaard for most of his 82 years. Although his material fortunes soon turned around dramatically, he was convinced that he had brought a curse on his family and that all his children were doomed to die by the age attained by Jesus Christ (33). Of Michael’s seven children, only Peter Christian and Søren Aabye survived beyond this age.

At age 12 Michael Kierkegaard was summoned to Copenhagen to work for his uncle as a journeyman in the cloth trade. Michael turned out to be an astute businessman and by the age of 24 had his own flourishing business. He subsequently inherited his uncle’s fortune, and augmented his wealth by some felicitous investments during the state bankruptcy of 1813 (the year, as Søren later put it, in which so many bad notes were put into circulation). Michael retired young and devoted himself to the study of theology, philosophy and literature. He bequeathed to his surviving sons Peter and Søren not only material wealth, but also supremely sharp intellect, a fathomless sense of guilt, and a relentless burden of melancholy. Although his father was wealthy, Søren was brought up rather stringently. He stood out at school because of his plain, unfashionable apparel and spindly stature. He learned to avoid teasing only by honing a caustic wit and a canny appreciation of other people’s psychological weaknesses. He was sent to one of Copenhagen’s best schools, The School of Civic Virtue [Borgerdydskolen], to receive a classical education. More than twice as much time was devoted to Latin in this school than to any other subject. Søren distinguished himself academically at school, especially in Latin and history, though according to his classmates he struggled with Danish composition. This became a real problem later, when he tried desperately to break into the Danish literary scene as a writer. His early publications were characterized by complex Germanic constructions and excessive use of Latin phrases. But eventually he became a master of his mother tongue, one of the two great stylists of Danish in his time, together with Hans Christian Andersen. Kierkegaard’s father is a constant presence in his authorship. He appears in stories of sacrifice, of inherited melancholy and guilt, as the archetypal patriarch, and even in explicit dedications at the beginning of several edifying discourses. Kierkegaard’s mother, on the other hand, never gets a mention in any of the writings – not even in his journal on the day of her death. His mother-tongue, though, is omnipresent. If we conjoin this fact with the remark in Concluding Unscientific Postscript (1846) that “… an omnipresent person should be recognizable precisely by being invisible,” we could speculate that the mother is even more present than the father, pervading all but the foreign language insertions in the texts. But whether or not there is any substance in this speculation, the invisibility of the mother and the treatment of women in general are indicative of Kierkegaard’s uneasy relationship with the opposite sex.

b. Regina Olsen: The Sacrifice of Love

Søren drifted into the study of theology at the University of Copenhagen, but soon broadened his study to include philosophy and literature. He started rather desultorily, and enjoyed a relatively dissolute time, even aspiring to cut the figure of a dandy. He ran up debts, which his father reluctantly paid, but eventually knuckled down to finish his degree when his father died in 1838. It seemed he was destined for a life as a pastor in the Danish People’s Church. In 1840, just before he enrolled at the Pastoral Seminary, he became engaged to Regina Olsen. This engagement was to form the basis of a great literary love story, propagated by Kierkegaard through his published writings and his journals. It also provided an occasion for Kierkegaard to define himself further as an outsider. For several years (at least since 1835) Kierkegaard had been dabbling with the idea of becoming a writer. The wealth he had inherited from his father enabled him to support himself comfortably without the need to work for a living. But it was not really enough to support a wife, let alone a wife and children. Furthermore, Kierkegaard harbored an undisclosed secret, something dark and personal, which he thought it his duty to confide to a wife, but which he dared not. Whether it was some sexual indiscretion, an inherited sexual disease, his innate melancholy, an egotistical mania to become a writer, or something else, we can only speculate. But when it came to the crunch, it seemed sufficient to make him break off the engagement rather than to reveal it to Regina. Thereafter, Kierkegaard frequently used marriage as a trope for “the universal” – especially for the universal demands made by social mores. Correlatively, becoming an “exception” was both a task and constantly in need of justification. The tortuous dialectic of universal and exception, worked out in terms of the sacrifices of love, subsequently informs much of Either/Or, Repetition, Fear and Trembling, Prefaces, and Stages on Life’s Way. A frequent foil for the trope of marriage as the universal is the figure of a young man “poeticized” by a broken engagement, who thereby becomes “an exception.” Only when the young man is “poeticized” in the direction of the religious, however, is there any question of his being a “justified exception.” Kierkegaard’s ultimate justification for breaking off his own engagement was his dedication to a life of writing as a religious poet, under the direction of divine Governance. As a measure of the importance the relationship to Regina had for his life, Kierkegaard adapted a line from Virgil’s Aeneid II,3 as “a motto for part of his life’s suffering”: Infandum me jubes Regina renovare dolorem (“Queen [Regina], the sorrow you bid me revive is unspeakable”).

c. The Master of Irony and the Seductions of Writing

During the period of his engagement Kierkegaard was also busy writing his Master’s dissertation in philosophy, On the Concept of Irony: with constant reference to Socrates (1841). This was later automatically converted to a doctorate (1854). Kierkegaard had petitioned the king to write his dissertation in Danish – only the third such request to be granted. Usually academic dissertations had to be written and defended in Latin. Kierkegaard was allowed to write his dissertation in Danish, but had to condense it into a series of theses in Latin, to be defended publicly in Latin, before the degree would be awarded. Almost immediately after his dissertation defense, Kierkegaard broke off his engagement to Regina. He then undertook the first of four journeys to Berlin – his only trips abroad apart from a brief trip to Sweden. During this first trip to Berlin Kierkegaard completed most of the first volume of Either/Or (much of the second volume already having been completed).

Throughout the second half of the 1830s Kierkegaard had aspired to become part of the pre-eminent literary set in Copenhagen. This centered on Professor J.L. Heiberg, playwright, philosopher, aesthetician, journal publisher, and doyen of Copenhagen’s literati. Heiberg had been credited with introducing Hegel’s philosophy to Denmark, though in fact there had already been lectures on Hegel by the Norwegian philosopher Henrik Steffens among others. Nevertheless, the fact that Heiberg gave Hegel’s work his imprimatur accelerated its acceptance into mainstream Danish intellectual life. By the end of the 1830s Hegelianism dominated Copenhagen’s philosophy, theology and aesthetics. Of course this engendered some resistance, including that from Kierkegaard’s professors of philosophy F.C. Sibbern and Poul Martin Møller. One of Hegelianism’s most illustrious local exponents was Kierkegaard’s archrival H.L. Martensen (professor of theology at Copenhagen University, later Bishop Primate of the Danish People’s Church). Martensen, just five years senior to Kierkegaard, was firmly entrenched in the Heiberg literary set, and anticipated at least one of Kierkegaard’s pet literary projects – an analysis of the figure of Faust. In his journals, as part of his practice at becoming a writer, Kierkegaard had been fascinated with three great literary figures from the Middle Ages, who he thought embodied the full range of modern aesthetic types. These figures were Don Juan, Faust, and the Wandering Jew. They embodied sensuality, doubt and despair respectively. Martensen’s publication on Faust pre-empted Kierkegaard’s budding literary project, though the latter eventually found expression in the first volume of Either/Or (1843). Meanwhile, Kierkegaard continued to seek Heiberg’s seal of approval. His first major breakthrough was an address to the University of Copenhagen’s Student Association on the issue of freedom of the press. This was a satirical conservative riposte to a previous address in favor of more liberal press laws, and was the first broadside by Kierkegaard in a long career of lambasting the popular press, especially insofar as it supported political agitation for democracy. In this instance, however, it seemed motivated more by a desire to showcase his wit and erudition than by any deeper engagement with the political issues. The freedom of the press had been severely undermined by King Frederik VI’s ordinance of 1799, and was threatened with full censorship by his press legislation of 1834. The Society for the Proper Use of Press Freedom was formed in 1835 to combat this development. Kierkegaard followed up his speech with an article in Heiberg’s paper, The Copenhagen Flying Post (1836). The article, published pseudonymously, was so clever and polished that some people mistook it for the work of Heiberg himself. This amounted to his calling card for invitation to the Heiberg literary salon. Kierkegaard followed this with further pseudonymous articles on the same topic. But his first monograph was a 70-page review of Hans Christian Andersen’s novel, Only a Fiddler. This too was a strategic move to break into the inner sanctum of Heiberg’s circle. Andersen was emerging as a major talent in Danish letters, having published poetry, plays and two novels, which had almost immediately been translated into German. Only a Fiddler was on a topic dear to Kierkegaard’s heart – genius. Andersen’s prime claim was that genius needs nurturing, and can succumb to circumstance and disappear without trace. Kierkegaard, in his book-length review From the Papers of One Still Living (1838), disagreed stridently, maintaining that the spark of genius could never be extinguished, but only augmented by adversity. Furthermore, he developed a theory of the novel in which he asserted that to be worth its salt, a novel had to be informed by a “life-view” and a “life-development.” He criticized Andersen’s novel for its dependence on contingent features from Andersen’s own life, rather than being transfigured by a mature philosophy of life with clarity of purpose. He contrasted Andersen’s novel unfavorably in this respect with the novel by Heiberg’s mother, Thomasine Gyllembourg, A Story of Everyday Life. Kierkegaard was to return to Gyllembourg as a novelist in his review of her Two Ages in A Literary Review (1846). He was also to write a review of the work of Heiberg’s wife Louise, Denmark’s leading actress, in The Crisis and A Crisis in the Life of an Actress (1848).

d. The “Authorship”: From Melancholy to Humor

Neither the articles in Heiberg’s papers, nor the monograph on Andersen as novelist had gained Kierkegaard secure membership of Heiberg’s circle – though he was an occasional visitor there. With the breaking of his engagement to Regina, the completion of a major academic book (The Concept of Irony), his decision to devote himself to writing, and the trip to Berlin both to audit Schelling’s lectures (along with Karl Marx, Jacob Burckhardt and other luminaries) and to concentrate on his new literary project (Either/Or), Kierkegaard was about to embark on what he later, retrospectively, called his “authorship.” This was eventually to comprise all the “aesthetic” pseudonymous works from Victor Eremita’s Either/Or to Johannes Climacus’s Concluding Unscientific Postscript, the Edifying Discourses under Kierkegaard’s own name (up to 1846), and Two Ages: The Age of Revolution and the Present Age: A Literary Review (by S. Kierkegaard). In short, these were the works published between Kierkegaard’s first and final visits to Berlin.

Either/Or burst upon the Copenhagen reading public with great force. It was immediately understood to be a major literary event. It was also regarded as scandalous by some, since its first volume portrayed the cynical, bored aestheticism of the modern flâneur, culminating in “The Seducer’s Diary.” Many, including Heiberg, took this to be a thinly disguised account of Kierkegaard’s own treatment of Regina Olsen. Most of the reviews, including Heiberg’s, concentrated on the scurrilous content of the first volume of the book. But other reviews read the two-volume work as a whole, and discovered the edifying and ethical framework in which the aesthetic point of view was to be assessed. Nevertheless, Heiberg’s review deeply offended Kierkegaard, and marked the point at which his relationship to Heiberg changed from aspiring associate to embittered critic. Hereafter in the “authorship” Heiberg became the target of unrelenting satire. He and Martensen were the main representatives of Danish Hegelianism, which is attacked at various points in the “authorship” – particularly in Prefaces (1844) and in Concluding Unscientific Postscript. It is worth noting that Hegel himself comes in for much less criticism, and much more positive endorsement, in Kierkegaard’s work than is commonly assumed. It is the Christian Hegelianism of Danish intellectuals that is the main target of his critiques. The “authorship” comprises two parallel series of texts. On the one hand are the pseudonymous works, which purportedly follow a dialectical trajectory of existential “stages” from the aesthetic, through the ethical, to the religious, and ultimately to the paradoxical religious stage of Christian faith. On the other hand are the Edifying Discourses, which are published under Kierkegaard’s own name, which resemble sermons on biblical texts, and which are addressed to a readership already presumed to be Christian. The pseudonymous authorship starts with an existential type modeled on the German Romantic aesthete – the ironic, urbane flâneur whose main concern is to avoid boredom and to maintain a cerebral spectator’s interest in life and its sensuous pleasures. Ironically, this aesthete is beset with melancholy. His greatest happiness is his unhappiness, as the section of Either/Or entitled “The Unhappiest One” concludes. Although boredom is stated to be the negative motivation for the aesthete’s actions, at a deeper level we can discern that it is escape from melancholy and despair that are the real motivators. As part of the dialectical framework of the “authorship,” Kierkegaard says there are also intermediate states between the discrete existential stages. These he calls “confinia” or border areas. Between the aesthetic and ethical stages lies the confinium of irony. Between the ethical and religious stages lies the confinium of humor. Humor is defined as “irony to a higher power” – so it does not wear its meaning on its sleeve. It is also to be understood as an inclusive, magnanimous state of affirming “both/and” (both the aesthetic and the ethical, both the tragic and the comic) rather than the ethically exclusive “either/or.” The author of Concluding Unscientific Postscript, Johannes Climacus is a self-professed “humorist” in this sense. Although he purports to give the reader the truth about Christianity, he also “revokes” all he has said in that book. The religious humorist purports to go beyond the aesthetic and the ethical by choosing the religious exclusively, yet by virtue of the absurd, gets the aesthetic and the ethical back again within the religious. In terms of his own psychological economy, Kierkegaard seems to have been struggling to lose his melancholy and have it at the same time. It seems to have served him as an essential motor of aesthetic productivity, but was also a constant source of suffering from which he sought escape. For a long time Kierkegaard reconciled himself to his life of aesthetic self-indulgence as an author with the idea that it was all for a limited time. Once his “authorship’ was complete, he would retire from writing and become a country pastor ministering to the souls of simple folk. Authorship was both a demonic temptation and a means of self-justification as an exception to the universal demands of society’s ethics. But just as he was on the point of completing the “authorship,” Kierkegaard managed to provoke an attack on himself by the press, which demanded further work as an author in response.

e. The “Second Authorship”: Self-Sacrifice, Love, Despair, and the God-Man

Kierkegaard provoked an attack on himself by the journal The Corsair. The journal, edited by the talented Jewish author Meïr Goldschmidt, specialized in ruthless satirical attacks on contemporary Danish authors. Yet, perhaps because of the esteem in which Goldschmidt held him, Kierkegaard had been spared. Kierkegaard found this favorable treatment offensive (partly out of vanity, ostensibly because of his ongoing critique of the press’s influence on public opinion). So he publicly challenged The Corsair to do its worst. It did. It launched a series of attacks on Kierkegaard, more personal than literary, and focused on his odd appearance and his relationship with Regina. In some wicked caricatures it portrayed him with one trouser leg shorter than the other, with a sway back, and riding on a woman’s (Regina’s) back with stick in hand. These caricatures made a laughing stock of Kierkegaard in Copenhagen, to the extent that he was mocked in the street and had to give up his habit of walking around the inner city to talk with all and sundry.

But it galvanized him to begin a “second authorship.” This time the edifying discourses under his own name were supplemented with works by the pseudonym Anti-Climacus. Anti-Climacus represents an idealized Christian point of view – one that Kierkegaard professed is higher than he had been able to achieve in his own life. The only other pseudonyms to appear in this “second authorship” were Inter et Inter, author of The Crisis and A Crisis in the Life of an Actress, and “H.H.” author of “Two Ethical-Religious Essays.” In addition the “second authorship” comprises: Works of Love (1847), The Sickness Unto Death (1849), Practice in Christianity (1850), as well as various edifying discourses, including Edifying Discourses in Various Spirits (1847), The Lily of the Field and the Bird of the Air (1849), Three Discourses at the Communion on Fridays (1849), Two Discourses at the Communion on Fridays (1851), and For Self-Examination (1851). He also published a retrospective self-interpretation of his writings to date, On My Work as an Author (under his own name – 1851). In addition Kierkegaard wrote various works at this time which he decided not to publish. The most significant of these are: The Book on Adler and The Point of View for My Work as an Author. The former gives a detailed analysis of the “phenomenon” of Adolph Adler, a pastor in the Danish People’s Church who claimed to have had a divine revelation. He was deemed mad by the church authorities and pensioned off. Adler had been a leading Hegelian in the 1840s, but on Kierkegaard’s analysis ends up being “a Satire on Hegelian Philosophy and the Present Age.” Kierkegaard makes an immanent critique of Adler’s writings to demonstrate their confusion and the absence of revelation. Kierkegaard published only the addendum to The Book on Adler as “The Difference between a Genius and an Apostle” in “Two Ethical Religious Essays.” The Point of View for My Work as an Author sets out Kierkegaard’s (retrospective) interpretation of his authorship. It is subtitled: “A Direct Communication, Report to History.” It explains in direct terms the dialectic of indirect communication, but Kierkegaard was uncertain whether its directness at that time was dialectically correct for the authorship and refrained from publishing it. The “second authorship” reintroduces various concepts from the “aesthetic authorship,” but “transfigured” by the light of Christian faith. One of the most significant of these is “despair,” which is a transfigured version of “anxiety.” Both concepts are illuminated by reference to the notion of sin, and both are constitutive of the dialectic of selfhood. Only by acknowledging our ultimate dependence on God’s grace is it possible to overcome despair, and to become a self (paradoxically by becoming as “nothing” before God). Another concept transfigured in the “second authorship” is “love.” In the “aesthetic authorship” “love” is understood in pagan terms, primarily as eros – or desire. Desire is preferential, based on a lack (we only desire what we don’t have, according to Plato’s Symposium), and is ultimately selfish. Christian love is understood as agape. It is self-sacrificing, directed to the neighbor (without personal preference), is conceived as a spiritual duty rather than a psychological feeling, and comes as a gift from God rather than from the attraction between human beings. Its only perfect model is in the person of Jesus Christ, the God-man. We can see in the journey from eros in the “aesthetic authorship” to agape in the “second authorship” a personal attempt by Kierkegaard to sublimate his selfish desire for Regina into a self-sacrificing universal duty to love the neighbor. On his own terms this is impossible for a human being to achieve alone. It is only possible if love as agape is received as a gift by the grace of God.

f. The Attack on the Danish People’s Church

The “authorship” and “second authorship” had been governed by Kierkegaard’s elaborate method of “indirect communication.” This method, inspired by Socrates and Christ, is designed to elicit self-examination from the reader in order to start the process of existential transfiguration that is entailed by Christian faith. It is designed to make it harder for the reader to appropriate the text objectively and dispassionately. Instead, the text is folded back on itself, layered with riddles and paradoxes, and designed to be a mirror in which the way the reader judges the text amounts to a self-judgment on the reader. The different works in the “authorships” are related to one another dialectically, so that a reader has to traverse a complicated journey to arrive at the threshold of Christian faith. The method of indirect communication requires meticulous attention to each word, and to the dialectical trajectory of the whole oeuvre. At times, the subtlety of the method nearly drove Kierkegaard to distraction, and he had to rely on the intervention of “Governance” [Styrelse], to let him know whether it was appropriate to publish the works he had written. On the Point of View for My Work as an Author: A Report to History, and The Book on Adler, failed to get Governance’s stamp of approval for publication.

But ultimately Kierkegaard began to think that this elaborate method of indirect communication, and his obsession with linguistic detail were temptations to the demonic. Besides, time was running out and some direct, decisive intervention in Danish church politics was necessary. This was precipitated by the death of the Bishop Primate of the Danish People’s Church, J.P. Mynster (1854). Mynster had been the family pastor in Michael Kierkegaard’s day, and Søren Kierkegaard had always had a filial respect for him. But when the new Bishop Primate elect, H.L. Martensen, announced that Mynster had been “a witness to the truth” Kierkegaard could not restrain himself. He launched a stinging attack on the established church in a series of articles in the newspaper Fædrelandet [The Fatherland], and by means of a broadsheet called The Instant [or more literally “The Glint of an Eye”](1855) and in a series of other short, sharp pieces including This Must Be Said, So Let It Be Said (1855), and What Christ Judges of Official Christianity (1855). On September 28th 1855 Kierkegaard collapsed in the street. A few days later he was admitted to Frederiksberg Hospital in Copenhagen, where he died on November 11th.

2. The “Aesthetic Authorship”

a. On the Concept of Irony and Either/Or

Although Kierkegaard explicitly leaves On the Concept of Irony out of his “authorship,” it functions as an important preface to that body of work. According to the theory of existential stages contained in the authorship, irony functions as a “confinium” [border area] between the aesthetic and the ethical. But it also functions as a point of entry to the aesthetic. As Kierkegaard argues in On the Concept of Irony, irony is a midwife at the birth of individual subjectivity. It is a distancing device, which folds immediate experience back on itself to create a space of self-reflection. In Socrates it is incarnated as “infinite negativity” – a force that undermines all received opinion to leave Socrates’ interlocutors bewildered – and responsible for their own thoughts and values. That is, Socratic irony forces his interlocutors to reflect on themselves, to distance themselves critically from their immediate beliefs and values.

Although the aesthetic can consist in immediate immersion in sensuous experience, as in the case of Don Juan, Kierkegaard’s most developed portrait is of the reflective aesthete in Either/Or volume 1. Faust is the first example of a reflective aesthete. He is lost in reflective ennui and craves a return to immediate experience. This is the basis of his attraction to Margarete, who embodies innocent immediacy. At its most extreme, the aesthete is unhappily and utterly self-alienated by means of temporal dislocation. “The Unhappiest One” – an echo of Hegel’s “unhappy consciousness” – hopes for that which can only be remembered, and remembers that which can only be hoped. He or she lives only in the modality of possibility and never in the modality of actuality, and therefore fails to be self-present. Yet, by means of reflective self-knowledge, the prudent rotation of moods and the arbitrary focus of interest, this “unhappiness” can be transformed into the greatest happiness for the aesthete. The “infinitizing” element of possibility becomes the realm of freedom, where even the most banal events can be “poeticized” by aesthetic sensibility. Actuality is transformed into nothing more than an occasion for generating reflective possibilities, rather than being an obstacle or a task. Johannes the seducer need see only a dainty ankle descending from a carriage to reconstruct the whole woman – just as Cuvier reconstructs the whole dinosaur from a single bone. The reconstruction, in the case of Johannes however, is not for the sake of knowing what’s real, but is for the sake of his own aesthetic titillation. If the actual doesn’t fit Johannes’ reflective desires, he manipulates it and himself until he generates a story that satisfies him. His seduction of Cordelia is not aimed at mere sexual consummation, but more at narrative consummation – she is to be used as an occasion, and manipulated in whatever ways Johannes deems necessary, to become the character in the story of seduction he has predetermined. But this detachment from the actual, by self-centered immersion in reflective possibility, is exactly what On the Concept of Irony had accused the German Romantics of achieving with their use of irony. The first volume of Either/Or just gives us a more developed version, artistically construed from the point of view of German Romantic irony. On the Concept of Irony had already argued for the necessity to go beyond immersion in irony, or mere possibility – to become a “master of irony,” so that irony could be used strategically for ethical and religious ends. The title Either/Or presents us with a choice between the aesthetic and the ethical. The first volume is written from the point of view of the reflective aesthete, who has run astray in possibility. Although its main theme is love, this is conceived selfishly as erotic desire. The papers that comprise volume 1 are written ad se ipsum [to himself]. The aesthete’s brilliant pyrotechnics are demonically self-enclosed, ironically cutting him off from genuine communication. The second volume, on the other hand, is written by a judge, who advocates transparency and openness in communication. It is written in the form of letters, as a direct communication to the aesthetic author of the first volume. The letters implore him to realize the limitations of his demonic self-enclosure, and to embrace his ethical duties to others. Whereas the paradigm of love in volume 1 is seduction, the paradigm of love in volume 2 is marriage. Marriage is a trope for the universal claims of civic duty. It requires an open, intimate, transparent, honest relation to an other. Yet the first section of volume 2 argues for the aesthetic validity of marriage. Judge Wilhelm wants to persuade the aesthete that ethical love is compatible with aesthetic love – that love in marriage does not exclude sensual enjoyment and love of beauty as such, but only the selfishness of lust for “the flesh.” The latter is a category excluded by Christianity. It pertains to the body and psyche, to the exclusion of spirit, which is the definitive Christian category. Yet the claims of the judge ring hollow. Either/Or is presented as a whole book, edited by Victor Eremita (the victorious hermit). It presents us with a radical, exclusive choice between the aesthetic and the ethical, yet the judge tries to show their compatibility in marriage. The final word of the book belongs neither to the aesthete, the judge, nor even to the pseudonymous editor, but to an anonymous parson. His sermon, “The Edification Which Lies In The Fact That In Relation To God We Are Always In The Wrong,” alerts the reader to the impossibility of escaping sin through ethics. The assumption shared by both the aesthete and the ethicist is that love can provide a means for ascent to the divine. Whereas erotic desire provides a means for the aesthete to ascend to a state of reflective possibility unconstrained by actuality, in which he becomes his own creator-god, the judge conceives ethical love to be a dialectical advance on aesthetic selfishness – in the direction of God. The whole pseudonymous authorship, from Either/Or to Concluding Unscientific Postscriptcan be read as a parody of the notion of a scala paradisi by means of which humans can ascend to the divine. The original model for this ladder to paradise is Plato’s account of love [eros] in the Symposium. But the model is appropriated by many subsequent writers, including Augustine and Johannes Climacus, a sixth century monk from Mt. Sinai, who wrote a book called Scala Paradisi. Kierkegaard borrows this name for his pseudonymous author of Philosophical Fragments and Concluding Unscientific Postscript. But it is in order to parody the notion that humans can ascend to the divine under their own power. Each of the pseudonymous books in the “authorship” makes a gesture of movement from human to divine, whether by means of the aesthetic sublime, ethical virtue, the religious leap of faith, or philosophical dialectics. But in each case the apparent movement is “revoked” in some way. Ultimately Kierkegaard endorses the Lutheran view that human beings are radically dependent on God to descend to us. Human beings have no inherent capacity for transcending their own immanence, but are completely reliant on God’s grace to connect with alterity.

b. Fear and Trembling and Repetition

The next two books in the pseudonymous authorship, Fear and Trembling and Repetition, are supposed to represent a higher stage on the dialectical ladder – the religious. They are supposed to have moved beyond the aesthetic and the ethical. Fear and Trembling explicitly problematizes the ethical, while Repetition problematizes the notion of movement. Fear and Trembling reconstructs the story of Abraham and Isaac from the Old Testament. It tries to understand psychologically, ethically and religiously what Abraham was doing in obeying an apparent command from God to sacrifice his son. It apparently concludes that Abraham is “a knight of faith” who is religiously justified in his “teleological suspension of the ethical.” The ethic in question here is the civic virtue championed by Judge Wilhelm in Either/Or – corresponding to Hegel’s Sittlichkeit [customary morality]. The end for which this ethic is suspended is the unconditional command of God. But such obedience raises difficult epistemological questions – how do we distinguish the voice of God from, say, a delusional hallucination? The answer, which induces fear and trembling, is that we can only do so by faith. Abraham can say nothing to justify his actions – to do so would return him to the realm of human immanence and the sphere of ethics. The difference between Agamemnon, who sacrificed his daughter Iphigenia, and Abraham is that Agamemnon could justify his action in terms of customary morality. The sacrifice, however painful, was demanded for the sake of the success of the Greek military mission against Troy. Such sacrifices, for purposes greater than the individuals involved, were intelligible to the society of the time. Abraham’s sacrifice would have served no such purpose. It was unjustifiable in terms of prevailing morality, and was indistinguishable from murder. The ineffability of Abraham’s action is underscored by the pseudonym Kierkegaard chose as author of Fear and Trembling, namely, Johannes de silentio. But while Fear and Trembling is supposed to have moved beyond the aesthetic and the ethical, its subtitle is “a dialectical lyric.” Although its subject matter is ineffable and its author silent, it effuses aesthetically on its theme. It ends with an “Epilogue” that asserts that, as far as love and faith go, we cannot build on what the previous generation has achieved. We have to begin from the beginning. We can never “go further.”

Repetition begins with a discussion of the analysis of motion by the Eleatic philosophers. It goes on to distinguish two forms of movement with respect to knowledge of eternal truth: recollection and repetition. Recollection is understood on the model of Plato’s anamnesis – a recovery of a truth already present in the individual, which has been repressed or forgotten. This is a movement backwards, since it is retrieving knowledge from the past. It can never discover eternal truth with which it was previously unacquainted. In contrast, repetition is defined as “recollection forwards.” It is supposed to be the definitive movement of Christian faith. The pseudonym Constantin Constantius congratulates the Danish language on the word “Gjentagelse” [repetition], which more literally means “taking again.” The emphasis in the Danish, then, is on the action involved in the repetition of faith rather than on the intellection involved in recollection. Christian faith is not a matter of intellectual reflection, but of living a certain sort of life, namely, imitating [repeating] the life of Christ. Despite this verbal analysis of the difference between recollection and repetition, the characters in Repetition fail to achieve religious repetition. The pseudonymous author fails in his attempt to repeat a journey to Berlin, and the “young man” who has been “poeticized” by love seems to move in the direction of the religious, but ultimately gets no further than religious poetry. He becomes obsessed with Job, the biblical paradigm of repetition. He substitutes the book of Job for the beloved he has rejected, even taking it to bed with him. But in the end the “young man” turns out to be no more than a fiction invented by Constantius as a psychological experiment. He falls back into the realm of aesthetics, of mere possibility, a figment for the psyche rather than the spirit.

c. Philosophical Fragments, The Concept of Anxiety, and Prefaces

In June 1844 Kierkegaard published three pseudonymous books: Philosophical Fragments, The Concept of Anxiety, and Prefaces. Philosophical Fragments, the first book by the pseudonym Johannes Climacus, tackles the question of how there can be an historical point of departure for an eternal truth. This picks up from Constantius’ discussion of the difference between repetition and recollection. But Johannes uses the perspective and vocabulary of philosophy, rather than Constantius’ aesthetic irony. He introduces the paradox of the Christian incarnation as the stumbling block for any attempts by reason to ascend logically to the divine. The idea that the eternal, infinite, transcendent God could simultaneously be incarnated as a finite human being, in time, to die on the cross is an offense to reason. It is even too absurd an idea for humans to have invented, according to Climacus, so the idea itself must have a transcendent origin. In order for humans to encounter transcendent, eternal truth other than through recollection, the condition for reception of that truth must also have come from outside. If we have Christian faith, it is Christ as teacher who is the condition for receiving this truth – and he is conceived, precisely, as an incursion of the transcendent deity into the realm of human immanence. There can be no ascent to this truth by reason and logic, contra Hegel, who tries to demonstrate that “universal philosophical science” ultimately reveals “the Absolute.”

The emphasis Climacus places on the paradox of the Christian incarnation, together with his assertion that this causes offense to reason, have prompted many to the view that Kierkegaard is an “irrationalist” about Christian faith. Some take this to mean that his view of faith is contrary to reason, or transcendent of reason – in either case, exclusive of reason. Others have sought to find means of reconciling Climacus’ claims with some more extended notion of reason. It is important in considering these issues to distinguish Kierkegaard’s position from that of his pseudonym, and to take into account the point of view from which this consideration is made. Kierkegaard’s main aim in having Climacus make these claims is to undermine the idea that philosophical reason can be used as a scala paradisi. His principle target is Hegelianism, but he is also trying to distinguish pagan (especially Platonic) epistemology from Christian epistemology. We must also bear in mind that under the influence of Christian faith, all experience is transfigured (“everything is new in Christ”). This includes the experience of reason, as well as ethics and aesthetics. Ethics, for example, might be teleologically suspended in faith, but is recouped within Christian faith – though it comes to have another meaning. It is no longer merely customary morality, but is the morality sanctioned by Christian love, which is deontological, centered on spirit rather than sympathy, self-sacrificing, and is mediated by God (the “third” in every love relation). Similarly aesthetics is transfigured under Christian faith, from self-serving reflections confined to the realm of possibility, to the beauty inherent in altruistic self-effacing acts of love. Reason itself comes to have another meaning under Christian faith, so that it no longer takes offense at the paradox, but recognizes its necessity given the exigencies of relating the transcendent to the immanent without reduction. Reason is recontextualized within existence, rather than being elevated to absorb the whole of existence. Prefaces: Light Reading for Certain Classes as the Occasion May Require reinforces the polemic against Hegel’s speculative ladder of reason. Although much of its content is devoted to satirical broadsides at J.L. Heiberg, H.L. Martensen, and the popular press in Copenhagen, its starting point is the paradox of philosophical prefaces articulated in the preface to Hegel’s The Phenomenology of Spirit. Hegel’s assumption is that a philosophical work should be a sort of Bildungsroman – a narrative by means of which the reader’s consciousness is dialectically developed in the course of reading. If we assume the reader is to learn something from the process of reading the book, then he or she will not be in a position to understand the conclusions of the book until they have worked their way through the content. By the time they reach the end they will be conditioned by what they have read to understand the conclusion. But a preface presents the conclusions to the book at the outset. It is really an anticipatory postface rather than a preface. The reader will really only be able to understand it after having read the book. It is meant for orientation of the reader on embarking on the voyage of self-development represented by the book. But if it is a direct bridge into the book, the subject matter itself, then it is really part of the book rather than a preface. If, on the other hand, it stands radically outside the book, then it can’t be a bridge into the book and is redundant. This gap between preface and book parallels the gap Hegel draws between “particular philosophical sciences” (such as aesthetics, and history of philosophy) and “universal philosophical science” (logic). The former must be used as a contingent starting point, commensurate with the limited knowledge of the reader, as a point of induction into logic. The particular can retrospectively be subsumed within the universal, but cannot be expanded to become the universal. It has been claimed, in accordance with this position, that if the reader understands the preface to Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit, he or she understands the whole of Hegel’s philosophy. But the condition for understanding the preface is already to understand the whole of Hegel’s philosophy. The pseudonymous author of Prefaces, Nicholas Notabene, is a pedant whose wife has forbidden him to be an author. He takes an author to be a writer of books, and with cunning sophistry decides to write nothing but prefaces “which are not the prefaces to any books.” Notabene’s prefaces are analogues of human immanence – no amount of expansion will make them bridges to the transcendent. All human immanence is a “preface” to the divine. Only once the divine has come to us (in the incarnation or through direct revelation) can we retrospectively understand the status of our prefatory lives as mere prefaces. For Kierkegaard there is only one book – the bible. We are never “authors” of books, but only readers of “the old familiar text handed down from the fathers.” On the same day as he published Prefaces Kierkegaard also published On the Concept of Anxiety by Vigilius Haufniensis [Watchman of the Harbor – namely, Copenhagen]. Its subtitle is “A Simple Psychologically Orienting Deliberation on the Dogmatic Issue of Hereditary Sin.” It is supposed to be a serious counterweight to the “light reading” of Prefaces. But it forms part of the same polemic against immanent human efforts to reach the divine. From the points of view of psychology and theological dogmatics it elaborates the theme of the sermon appended to Either/Or – that against God we are always in the wrong. Sin is inescapable. Sin ultimately consists in being outside of God. Only Jesus Christ, the God-man, is not in sin. Sin consciousness comes into being as part of human psychological development. It is absent from the innocent immediacy of childhood. It awakens with sexual desire – when we want to possess another. Desire is here understood as a lack that we want to fill. Possession, or incorporation of the other, is thought to be the way to fulfill the desire. In erotic love it feels as though part of ourselves is outside of us, and needs to be reintegrated (as in Aristophanes’ explanation of love in Plato’s Symposium). This is the beginning of self-alienation and the loss of innocent immediacy. Self-alienation is a necessary stage on the way to becoming a self. A self is a synthesis of finite and infinite, temporal and eternal, body and soul, held together by spirit. Only with the diremption of these aspects of the self, through self-alienation, does spirit arise. But spirit can only achieve the synthesis of self if it acknowledges its absolute dependence in this task on God (“the power that posits it”). Long before it gets to this stage, the person feels anxiety in the face of self-alienation. Anxiety is an ambivalent state, “a sympathetic antipathy and an antipathetic sympathy.” It is the intimation of the delights of freedom, but also of the dread responsibility that is a consequence of freedom. Like vertigo, it is the simultaneous fascination and fear of the abyss – a hypnotic possibility of falling that induces the dizziness to actually fall. The main arena for the exercise of freedom is in becoming a self. But this requires alienation from one’s immediate sensate being, taking ethical responsibility for one’s relations to other people, and acknowledgement of one’s ultimate dependence on God. Each of these entails risk – and hence anxiety. One of the risks involved is the possibility of falling prey to the demonic. A key definition of this notion is “self-enclosed reserve” [Indesluttethed] – a state in which the individual fails to relate to an other as other, but returns into him or herself in narcissism or solipsism. Kierkegaard feared that his convoluted, indirect writing could be his own form of the demonic, and ultimately opted for more direct forms of communication.

d. Stages on Life’s Way and Concluding Unscientific Postscript

Like many of Kierkegaard’s pseudonymous works, Stages on Life’s Way repeats elements from earlier pseudonymous works. In particular, it repeats the device of nesting narrators within narrators, it repeats characters from Either/Or and Repetition, and it “repeats” “The Seducer’s Diary” in “Quidam’s Diary.” The latter was originally conceived at the same time as “The Diary of the Seducer” but was to differ by having the seducer undermined by his own depression once he had won the girl. Stages also repeats the idea built up over the sequence of pseudonymous works that human existence can be conceived as falling into distinct “stages” or “spheres,” which are related in a dialectical progression. Stages repeats the same stages that have already been traversed in the preceding works, apparently without making any progress.

It is another example of the false ladder to paradise, exemplified by Plato’s ladder of eros. The first major section of Stages, “In Vino Veritas,” borrows its title from Plato’s Symposium and is modeled explicitly on that work, both structurally and thematically. It consists in a group of men at a banquet, each discoursing in turn on the nature of (erotic) love. This section of the book is followed by “Some Reflections on Marriage” by Judge Wilhelm, to give an ethical perspective on love. This is followed by “Quidam’s Diary,” which is supposed to follow a trajectory from erotic love to religious consciousness. But Quidam’s diary is framed by the words of Frater Taciturnus (a distorted repetition of Johannes de silentio), in which he tells us that Quidam’s diary was retrieved from the bottom of a lake. It was enclosed in a box with the key locked inside – a symbol of the demonic. Later Frater Taciturnus tells the reader explicitly that Quidam is demonic “in the direction of the religious.” Furthermore, like the “young man” from Repetition, Quidam is only a fiction invented by Frater Taciturnus to illustrate a point. As we read through Stages it looks as though we are progressing from the aesthetic, through the ethical to the religious. But Frater Taciturnus pulls the ladder out from under our feet in his “Letter to the Reader.” He even suggests that there might not be any reader, in which case he is content to talk to himself – i.e. return demonically into himself, rather than relate himself earnestly to an actual other. Concluding Unscientific Postscript repeats these movements of Stages. It proclaims itself to be only a postscript to the Philosophical Fragments, which any attentive reader of that book could have written, and contains an extensive review of the pseudonymous authorship to date. The self-proclaimed humorist, Johannes Climacus takes up the problematic of Philosophical Fragments of whether there can be an historical point of departure for eternal truth. He seems to conclude that since it is impossible to demonstrate the objective truth of Christianity’s claims, the most the individual can do is to concentrate on the how of appropriation of those claims. This issues in the extensive discussion of inwardness and subjectivity, which is usually taken as the basis for the accusation that Kierkegaard is an “irrationalist.” Climacus, but not Kierkegaard, proclaims that “truth is subjectivity” (as well as “subjectivity is untruth”). Climacus also makes a distinction between two types of religiousness: “Religiousness A” and “Religiousness B.” The former is the pagan conception of religion and is characterized by intelligibility, immanence, and recognition of continuity between temporality and eternity. Religiousness B is dubbed “paradoxical religiousness” and is supposed to represent the essence of Christianity. It posits a radical divide between immanence and transcendence, a discontinuity between temporality and eternity, yet also claims that the eternal came into existence in time. This is a paradox and can only be believed “by virtue of the absurd.” The distinction between “Religiousness A” and “Religiousness B” is another expression of the distinction between recollection and repetition, or between eros and agape, or between immanence and transcendence. It is supposed to mark the gulf between Christianity and all other forms of faith. The paradox of the Christian incarnation is presented as an offense to reason, which can only be overcome by a leap of faith. But even a leap is under the control of the individual. It might take more courage and induce more anxiety than the steady step-by-step ascension of a ladder. One is out over 70000 fathoms. But Climacus is a humorist. Humor is characterized as a means of “revoking” existence. Although Climacus writes about Christian faith, he doesn’t live it. He represents in the modality of possibility what can only be experienced in the modality of actuality. At the end of Concluding Unscientific Postscript, Climacus explicitly revokes everything he has said – though he is careful to add that to say something and revoke it is not the same as never having said it at all. That is, at the end of the pseudonymous scala paradisi, the pseudonymous author proclaims that what he has said is misleading – because it presents a continuity between immanent human categories of thought and the divine in the form of analogy. But there is no analogy to the divine. It is sui generis. It is “the book” to human life as “preface.”

3. The Edifying Discourses

a. Sermons, Deliberations, and Edifying Discourses

Simultaneously with the publication of the aesthetic pseudonymous works, Kierkegaard published a series of works he called “Edifying Discourses” [Opbyggelige Taler]. These were written under his own name and most of them were dedicated “To the Late Michael Pedersen Kierkegaard, Formerly a Clothing Merchant Here in the City, My Father.” Although they typically take a New Testament theme as their point of departure, Kierkegaard explicitly denies that they are sermons. This is because he had not been ordained, and so wrote “without authority.” They are also addressed to “that single individual” and not to a congregation.

Kierkegaard distinguishes his “edifying discourses” as a genre from other works he calls “deliberations” [Overveielser]. Edifying discourses “build up” whereas deliberations are a “weighing up.” Edifying discourses presuppose Christian faith and terminology as given and understood, and build on that. They are meant to augment the faith and love of the Christian reader. Deliberations, while they may ostensibly deal with the same subject matter, imply that the reader stands outside the matter being weighed. But this is in a particular sense. In weighing something on a scale, we measure two weights against one another. In deliberating, the reader weighs the temporal significance of the subject matter against its eternal significance. The deliberation, as a type of writing, weighs into the reader’s balance of temporal and eternal with polemical force. It is meant to turn the normal, worldly view topsy-turvy. Works of Love is subtitled “Some Christian Deliberations in the Form of Discourses.” It has the polemical, topsy-turvy nature of deliberation, but contains within it the form of the discourse. Furthermore, one of the explicit themes of these discourses is edification. But because of the framework of deliberation, the discourses about edification are not necessarily for edification. They don’t presuppose an understanding of the Christian categories, but are meant to lead the reader to an understanding – through deliberation. The earlier pseudonymous book, The Concept of Anxiety is subtitled “A Simple Psychologically Orienting Deliberation on the Dogmatic Issue of Hereditary Sin.” Like Works of Love it is a serious weighing up of various Christian concepts, in a manner designed to provoke readers to rethink the relation between the temporal and eternal in their lives. Kierkegaard uses yet other related genres besides deliberations and edifying discourses. The pseudonym Anti-Climacus uses the subtitles “A Christian Psychological Exposition [Udvikling] for Edification and Awakening” (The Sickness Unto Death) and “For Awakening and Making Inward” (Practice in Christianity). These are written from an idealized Christian point of view, so not only presuppose an understanding of the Christian categories, but seek to raise the level of awareness to the highest level of Christian faith.

b. Direct and Indirect Communication

Kierkegaard struggled to find appropriate means of communication that would address the inward nature of Christian faith. He thought his contemporaries had too much (objective) knowledge, which needed stripping away, before they could achieve awareness of individual inwardness. Everything was made too easy for people, with the press providing ready-made opinions, popular culture providing ready-made values, and speculative philosophy providing promissory notes in place of real achievements. Kierkegaard’s task as a communicator was, initially, to make things more difficult. In order to do this, he devised a method of indirect communication. This was designed to confront the reader with paradox, contradiction, and difficulty by means of refraction of the narrative point of view through pseudonyms, prefaces, postscripts, interludes, preliminary expectorations, repetitions, irony, revocation and other devices that obscure the author’s intention. These devices are meant to undermine the authority of the author, so any “truths” contained in the text cannot merely be learned by rote or appropriated “objectively.” Instead, the text is meant to supply a polished surface in which the reader comes to see him or herself. The manner in which the reader appropriates the text, understands it, and judges it will disclose more about the reader than about the text.

Part of the method of indirect communication was to juxtapose two series of texts: the pseudonymous texts and the “edifying discourses.” The latter were published under Kierkegaard’s own name, and were co-extensive with the pseudonymous authorship. They are evidence that he was a religious author from the outset. The indirect method of the pseudonymous works is often convoluted, obscure, and a combination of personal confession and obfuscation (of those confessions). The whole of the pseudonymous authorship from Either/Or to Concluding Unscientific Postscript can be read as a parody of Hegel’s Encyclopedia of the Philosophical Sciences – an enormously baroque conceit that threatens to become demonic in its obscurity and labyrinthine complexity. This complexity is balanced by the relatively simple thematic variations on biblical texts to be found in the edifying discourses. The latter were direct communications – but addressed only to Christians who could understand them. The indirect works, on the other hand, were designed to seduce or deceive into the truth those who stand outside it – such as the Danish Hegelians and their followers. By parodying Hegel’s Encyclopedia, Kierkegaard was undermining the whole system on which the Danish Hegelians placed so much faith. He supplemented his parody of Hegel with more specific jibes at particular Danish Hegelians throughout the “authorship.” Kierkegaard continued to write edifying discourses in conjunction with the “second authorship,” to accompany the works of the pseudonym Anti-Climacus. After the “second authorship” he wrote Christian discourses that were more polemical and strident than the edifying discourses. They were equally “direct” – being published under his own name, but addressed different emotions and values.

c. That Single Individual, My Reader

Kierkegaard’s edifying discourses are addressed to “that single individual, my reader.” When he first used this address he meant it to apply to Regina Olsen. But he came to see that it had a wider application. He had polemicized from his earliest writings against the press, and against cultural and political tendencies to “level” individuals into homogeneous masses. His term of loathing for the depersonalized, de-individualized instrument of leveling was “the crowd.” It corresponds to Nietzsche’s notion of “the herd” and to Heidegger’s notion of “das Man.” One subset of “the crowd” that especially attracted Kierkegaard’s ire was “the reading public.” This was the anonymous mass, consumer of the secondhand literary opinion of “reviewers.” Most reviewers, in Kierkegaard’s opinion, were hasty, ill-informed panderers to public opinion, so that reviewers and public fed off each other in a vicious circle. Reviews were even written without the reviewer having read the book, then circulated through gossip by “the reading public” as final judgment on the book. The anonymous circulation of public gossip is the antithesis of serious engagement with truth on a personal level.

Christianity addresses the single individual. Its truths, according to Kierkegaard, must be appropriated inwardly, seriously and with infinite passion. Just as we cannot die another’s death, we cannot live another’s faith. Existing inwardly in passion as an individual is a prerequisite for Christian faith. Having Christian faith is a prerequisite for understanding the edifying discourses. So the edifying discourses are addressed to each single individual. The pseudonymous works in the aesthetic authorship often have letters addressed to the reader too. But, as in the case of the letters of Constantine Constantius and Frater Taciturnus, they turn out to be soliloquies addressed to themselves more than direct, open communications to a reader posited as genuinely other.

4. The “Second Authorship”

a. Works of Love

Works of Love was written under Kierkegaard’s own name. Its subtitle places it within the genre of “Christian deliberations” – i.e. polemical weighings-up of Christian notions. It does not presuppose an existential understanding of Christian love, as it would were it an “edifying discourse,” but challenges the reader to open him or herself to the specifically Christian understanding of love. For a reader who understands love principally in terms of eros, the Christian notion of love as agape is counterintuitive. Whereas eros is a preferential feeling of desire, agape is a spiritual duty to serve the neighbor (without discrimination in terms of preference). Whereas eros is ultimately selfish, aimed at satisfying the lover’s desire, agape is selfless, requiring self-sacrifice. Whereas eros is often built on the visual objectification of the beloved, agape requires the individual to become “transparent” and “as nothing” before God. Whereas eros is typically a relation between two people, agape always involves God as the “third” in the relation.

Works of Love concentrates not so much on the understanding of love as such, but on the understanding of works of love. Love will be known as the fruit of these works of love. Since God is love, it can only be known through the existential commitment of Christian faith. This faith is only lived in the attempt to imitate the life of Christ. Christ’s life was itself God’s principal work of love for human beings. It is only through this work of love that we can know God as love. The only true work of love is helping someone else achieve autonomy through Christian love. But if that person sees that he or she was dependent on some other human being to achieve autonomy, that autonomy will be undone. The human author of a work of love must disappear in the act of love, so that only the love is perceived and only God is recognized as its author. This presents Kierkegaard with a difficult task in writing Works of Love. If it helps its readers achieve autonomy through an understanding of Christian love, and the readers recognize Kierkegaard to be the author, it will fail to be a work of love. Kierkegaard has to disappear as author in order for the book to function as a work of love. He resorts to the device of the dash [Tankestreg] to achieve his disappearance. He explicitly talks about this use of the dash during the course of Works of Love, and ends the penultimate section of the book with a dash (unfortunately omitted from the English translation). The conclusion that follows the dash is a presentation of the words of the Apostle John. As an Apostle, John presents the word of God. The word of God is a record of the life of Christ, which is God’s work of love. So God’s word is the work of love. Kierkegaard, by means of the dash, erases his ego as an author to allow the word of God to shine through – thereby preserving Works of Love as a work of love.

b. Anti-Climacus

Anti-Climacus is the pseudonymous author of two of Kierkegaard’s mature works: The Sickness Unto Death (1849) and Practice in Christianity (1850). As his name indicates, Anti-Climacus represents the antithesis of Johannes Climacus. As we have seen, Climacus derives his name from the monk who wrote Scala Paradisi, thereby embracing the idea that it is possible for human beings to ascend to heaven under their own power. The “aesthetic” authorship, culminating in Concluding Unscientific Postscript, explores a number of possible modes of scaling heaven – by means of erotic love, the Babel tower of aesthetic poetry, ethical works, or speculative reason. All are found wanting. Having established the absolute nature of transcendence through repeated parodies of these vain attempts in the aesthetic authorship, Kierkegaard proceeds to show through Anti-Climacus how various aesthetic concepts are transfigured from an ideal Christian point of view.

The central notions explored in The Sickness Unto Death are “despair” and “the self.” In this respect it is a Christian repetition of the central themes of The Concept of Anxiety, with “despair” supplanting “anxiety.” Both explore the task of becoming a self from the points of view of psychology and Christian faith. Both invoke sin as the greatest obstacle to becoming a self. Yet paradoxically, becoming conscious of sin is a prerequisite for faith and selfhood. Anti-Climacus distinguishes between “human being” and “self.” The human being is a synthesis, of infinite and finite, temporal and eternal, freedom and necessity, body and soul. The self, on the other hand, is the process of relating these elements of synthesis to one another. The self is the task of maintaining the proper equilibrium of the synthesis. But this task is beyond the capacity of a mere human being alone. Willing to be a self is itself a form of despair. Not willing to be a self is also a form of despair. Being unaware of the possibility of being a self is also a form of despair. The only antidote to despair is Christian faith. Faith provides the missing element in the synthesis, namely, an acknowledgement of God as the necessary underpinning of the self-relation. But to become aware of God, one first has to become aware of one’s absolute difference from God. This is the function of sin-consciousness. Sin-consciousness presupposes God-consciousness. The ultimate form of despair is despairing over one’s sin, and thereby failing to accept God’s forgiveness. Only through the movement of faith can God’s grace be received and accepted, thereby acknowledging God’s absolute alterity as well as our absolute dependence on God to be selves. Practice in Christianity complements The Sickness Unto Death thematically. It deals with the appropriate Christian response to divine grace, and with healing through penitence. But it also repeats some of the themes of Philosophical Fragments and Concluding Unscientific Postscript. In particular it revisits the themes of offense and the historical point of departure for eternal truth. The latter is explored under the rubric of becoming contemporary with the absolute. Christian faith is the only means for the immanent, temporal human being to have contact with the transcendent, eternal truth, since that faith consists in believing that Christ was the incarnation of God. That faith consists not merely in intellectual belief, but in willingness to imitate the life of Christ to the utmost of one’s powers. Anti-Climacus catalogues various ways in which we might take offense at someone claiming to be the “God-man.” In the process he discusses the necessity for God, as transcendent, to use a method of indirect communication. The God-man needs to be “incognito” – to arrive in the unrecognizable form of a servant. He needs to suffer, to be spurned, to avoid any possible direct revelation of His exalted status. Only by means of indirect communication, rather than by direct revelation, will the individual come to relate to the God-man through faith. The possibility of faith is the obverse of the possibility of offense. Offense is underscored by means of the Almighty’s lowly incognito and indirect method of communication.

c. The Attack on the Church

Kierkegaard came to think that perhaps indirect communication should be the exclusive provenance of the God-man. He came increasingly to regard his own indirection, and his love affair with language, to be demonic temptations. When the Bishop Primate of the Danish People’s Church, his father’s old pastor J.P. Mynster, died in January 1854, Kierkegaard felt free to attack the established church more directly and stridently. He had suppressed some critical and potentially offensive writings while Mynster was still alive. But he was precipitated into a full frontal attack when the new Bishop Primate, H.L. Martensen, Kierkegaard’s old rival, publicly described the late Mynster as “a witness to the truth.” Kierkegaard had respected Mynster as a pastor and a man, but found his administration of the church wanting. Mynster had steered the church into closer relations with the state, and had shored up the values of “Christendom” rather than “Christianity.” The former was a phenomenon of cultural history; the latter was the vehicle of passionate, inward individual faith. Given the leveling tendencies of “the present age,” Christendom as a cultural phenomenon was on a collision course with Christian faith. It threatened to replace “the single individual” with “the crowd” (under the guise of “the congregation”), struggle with mediation, revolution with reflection, and works of love with the welfare state. Worst, it threatened to usurp eternal truth with temporal gossip. Therefore, to call its chief spokesman a “witness to the truth” provoked an extreme reaction from Kierkegaard.

His discourses changed from gentle edifications to strident calls to arms. He moved from a position of “armed neutrality” with respect to church politics, to one of decisive intervention in “the instant.” “The Instant” [Øieblikket – literally ‘the glint of an eye’] was Kierkegaard’s final frenetic publication. The Concept of Anxiety had identified “the instant” as the point of intersection of time and eternity. It is the moment of decision, the moment of transfiguring vision, the moment of contemporaneity with Christ. It was also the moment to let go of indirect communication and to speak directly. “The Instant” was the name of a broadsheet Kierkegaard published to continue his attack on the state church. He published ten issues between its inception in May 1855 and the last in September 1855, when he collapsed and was admitted to hospital. But to speak directly, having spoken for so long indirectly, is not the same as the “objective” direct communication he originally resisted. It was not a direct communication about eternal truth, but a timely intervention in contemporary politics. It was a verbal act, rather than a measured contribution to literature. Another important part of the “second authorship” consists in the self-reflections Kierkegaard wrote on his own work as an author. In 1851 he published On My Work as an Author, but had also written several other works that were only published posthumously. These include The Point of View for my Work as an Author: A Report to History (1859), Armed Neutrality, or My Position as a Christian Author in Christendom (1880), and “Three Notes Concerning my Activity as an Author” (1859). He also withheld from publication The Book on Adler, an extended study of Adolph Adler, a prominent Hegelian and pastor in the Danish People’s Church. Adler claimed to have received divine revelation, but Kierkegaard’s analysis of his writings tries to demonstrate Adler’s confusion. Adler becomes, in Kierkegaard’s words, “a Satire on Hegelian Philosophy and the Present Age.” Kierkegaard also used Adler’s case to distinguish between “a genius” and “an apostle.” Another work, also published posthumously, was “The Ethical and Ethico-religious Dialectic of Communication” (1877). Kierkegaard agonized over whether to publish these direct communications about his own strategies of communication and how he saw his activity as an author. Of particular concern was how these direct writings would affect the complex dialectic of direct and indirect communications he had set up in his “authorships.” Ultimately he relied on the guidance of “Governance” [Styrelse] to decide whether or not to publish – much as Socrates had relied on the warnings of his daimonion about whether to engage people in philosophical cross-examination. Retrospectively, Kierkegaard regarded his activity as an author to have been under the direction of Governance. He had not had a clear view at the outset about the structure of his authorships, but had come to see that what he had been directed to write was what was required for a religious poet in the present age. He was a writer who overflowed with ideas – far too many to write down. Therefore Governance had to sit him down like a schoolboy, and make him write as though he were writing “a work assignment.” In much the same way as he disappeared under the dash in works of love, Kierkegaard “disappears” in these accounts of his own activity as a writer under the sign of “Governance.”

5. References and Further Reading

Kierkegaard’s Writings

Danish

• Breve og Aktstykker vedrørende Søren Kierkegaaard, ed. Niels Thulstrup, Copenhagen: Munksgaard, 1953-4.
• Søren Kierkegaards Papirer, ed. P.A. Heiberg, V. Kuhr & E. Torsting, second edition Niels Thulstrup, Copenhagen: Gyldendal, 1968-78.
• Søren Kierkegaards Samlede Værker, ed. A.B. Drachmann, J.L. Heiberg & H.D. Lange, second edition, Copenhagen: Nordisk Forlag, 1920-36.
• Søren Kierkegaards Skrifter, ed. N.J. Cappelørn, et.al., Copenhagen: Gad, 1997-.
• English Kierkegaard’s Writings volumes 1-XXVI, ed. & trans. H.V. Hong, et.al. Princeton University Press: 1978-2000.

Commentary

• Cappelørn, Niels Jørgen, Hermann Deuser, et.al. (eds), Kierkegaard Studies Yearbook 1996-, Berlin & New York: Walter de Gruyter, 1996-
• Ferreira, M. Jamie, Love’s Grateful Striving: A Commentary on Kierkegaard’s Works of Love, Oxford University Press, 2001
• Garff, Joakim, SAK: Søren Aabye Kierkegaard: en biografi, Copenhagen: Gad, 2000
• Hannay, Alastair, Kierkegaard: A Biography, Cambridge University Press, 2001
• Hannay, Alastair & Gordon Marino (eds), The Cambridge Companion to Kierkegaard, Cambridge University Press, 1998
• Kirmmse, Bruce, Encounters With Kierkegaard, Princeton University Press, 1996
• Kirmmse, Bruce, Kierkegaard in Golden Age Denmark, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1990
• Mackey, Louis, Points of View: Readings of Kierkegaard, Tallahassee: Florida State University Press, 1986
• Malantschuk, Gregor, Kierkegaard’s Thought, ed. & trans. H.V. Hong & E.H. Hong, Princeton University Press, 1971
• Pattison, George, Kierkegaard: The Aesthetic and the Religious, New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1992
• Perkins, Robert L (ed.), International Kierkegaard Commentary, Macon: Mercer University Press
  • This is a series of anthologies of essays, with each volume designed to accompany the volumes comprising Kierkegaard’s Writings, op.cit.

Author Information

William McDonald
Email: wmcdonal@metz.une.edu.au
University of New England
Australia