Richard M. Gale (1932—2015)

R.M. Gale courtesay of daughterRichard Gale was an American philosopher known for defending the A-theory of time against the B-theory. The A-theory implies, for example, that tensed predicates are not reducible to tenseless predicates. Gale also argued against the claim that negative truths are reducible to positive ones. He created a new modal version of the cosmological argument for God’s existence, which he later refined with Alexander Pruss. The argument generated considerable interest in the philosophical community. He produced some interesting and sometimes controversial interpretations of both William James and John Dewey. In The Divided Self of William James, he argued that James is a Promethean pragmatist who attempts to ground all truth in ethics. In John Dewey’s Quest for Unity, he represented Dewey as a Promethean pragmatist who holds that human beings are creators of meaning. Gale argued that Dewey attempts to combine this with his own type of mysticism, while never achieving a successful synthesis.

Gale worked at New York University, Hunter College, and Vassar before joining the University of Pittsburgh in 1964 where he remained until retiring in 2003. He was the editor of three books, the author of eight, and he published over one hundred philosophical articles, critical studies, and book reviews.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. The Philosophy of Time
  3. Negation and Non-Being
  4. The Philosophy of Religion
    1. The Nature and Existence of God
    2. The Gale-Pruss Cosmological Argument
  5. Pragmatism
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
      1. Books Edited
      2. Books Authored
      3. Articles
      4. Book Reviews
      5. Critical Studies
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Richard Gale was born on July 13, 1932 and raised on the upper West Side of Manhattan where he attended public schools. Gale describes an uneventful childhood in which he was an average student. However, his older sister Zelda was a brilliant student—a fact of which his teachers never tired of reminding him, and which, he opines, may have initiated the distrust of school teachings that lasted throughout his life. He recalls a strange sense of detachment during that period, feeling as if he were a visiting cultural anthropologist from Arcturus observing the habits of strange earthlings. This, Gale remarks, prepared him for the detached viewpoint of the philosopher, “the spectator of all time and eternity, bent on trying to understand a world that was not worth taking seriously.” Gale remarks that outward observers would not have felt he was so “out of it” because he dutifully followed all the rituals of “the tribe”, reciting the Pledge of Allegiance, singing the national anthem, and attending Sunday school at the Park Avenue Synagogue which, he wryly notes, “wasn’t on Park avenue”. Although Gale did not have any personal interest in religious questions after his teenage years, one positive experience in his youth was conversing with Rabbi Milton Steinberg, “a very great man”. His main interest at this time was athletics. Gale describes himself as a great player in practice who “stank” in the games because he could not relax. He liked philosophy because it did not require one to perform well in the crucial moment. One can think and rethink it in private until one gets it right. It is fortunate, Gale remarks, that he did not become a brain surgeon.

Gale’s other interest in his youth was music, especially jazz. His father owned the Savoy Ballroom and managed Chick Webb, Ella Fitzgerald, Cab Calloway, and the Ink Spots. He booked many leading black jazz musicians of the day, including Dizzy Gillespie, Charley Parker, Lester Young, Art Tatum, Errol Garner, and Sarah Vaughn, many of whom Gale knew as a teenager. He studied a version of the Schillinger system of musical composition and arranging with Edgar Sampson and organized a six piece combo in high school in which he played piano and did the arrangements. Gale remarks that “after almost every gig we had to change our name so we could get another job”. He began with “Richard Gale and His Manhattan Serenaders,” followed by “Richard Gale and His Rhumba Orchestra,” and, eventually, “Richard Gale and His Society Orchestra.” His “typical gig” was a bar mitzvah in Brooklyn where they were not paid but could eat as much as they wanted. “We were,” Gale admits, “a very oral bunch of guys.”

Gale did not want to go to college but gave in to his parents. Given his expectation that he would go into his father’s music business, he pursued a Bachelor of Music degree at Ohio Wesleyan University where he soon discovered that he had “everything that it took to be a great composer except talent”. His strategy was to write twelve tone musical compositions because he thought he would not be criticized for them because no one would expect to understand them. When one of his compositions was performed at the college the best his friends could say was “Very interesting,” which, Gale inferred, meant they hated it.

Since most of Gale’s time was put into his music classes and the Air Force Reserve Officer Training Corps, he had little time for other subjects. Recognizing that his career as a great composer was not on the cards, and, having no idea what philosophy was, he took a philosophy course taught by William Quillian, Jr. Here, he finally found what he was hungering for, something one does for its own sake, but he “did not know what it was”. Gale became an outstanding student in philosophy classes though he still laboured to get B’s in his other courses. Several of his junior year essays received prizes, enabling him to “step out of my sister’s shadow and … believe in myself”. He credits Lloyd Easton, who specialized in American Hegelianism, as his best teacher. A guest lecture on Dewey by George Raymond Geiger, whose “brilliance and humour blew me away,” inspired him to write his senior thesis on Kant’s and Dewey’s aesthetic theories under Easton and visiting professor G.P. Conger. He found Conger, best known for his Theories of Macrocosms and Microcosms in the History of Philosophy, a “delightful and fascinating man.” Years later Gale described his senior thesis as “the work of a mad dog Deweyite that made Kant look like he should have had his tenure revoked.”

Upon graduation in 1954 Richard served two years as an intelligence officer in Japan, which he “loved”. After leaving the Air Force, he joined his father’s music business at BMI as a “song plugger”. His job was to “romance” disc jockeys to “get them to play our songs.” The company had many big hits at that time including Elvis Presley’s “Don’t Be Cruel” and “All Shook Up.” Richard soon discovered that he “hated” the business because to be successful one had to manipulate people into doing one favours and he feared that he was “turning into the sort of person who is successful in this business”.

During this time he took a two-semester night course at NYU on existentialism with William Barrett, where reading Kierkegaard’s Fear and Trembling became “the most important event in my life.” Fear and Trembling was “the moral goose I needed to give me the strength and courage to leave the music business” and “do what I really loved.” He was fascinated by Barrett’s portrait of Kierkegaard’s “knight of infinite faith who can achieve authenticity only through making” a decision that appears “absurd to the world.” The music business “was my Regina!” His parents were not amused. Gale left the music business and began graduate studies at NYU in 1957. During this period he met his wife Maya Mori, who had just graduated with a degree in fine arts from Nihon University in Tokyo and was studying interior design in the United States. Two and a half years later they married.

Although perhaps not the usual experience, Gale found graduate school to be “paradise”: “Every day I had to pinch myself to believe that one could really make a living doing philosophy …” Gale published several of his term papers in respected professional journals but admits that he had a big advantage over his peers. Since normal graduate students had not suffered the horror of the music business they were at a motivational disadvantage. Gale later described his early publications as proof of the danger of rushing into premature publication, remarking that Walter Stace, for whom he had written one of them, told him that his courage exceeded his ability

Gale’s chose NYU because he was “an ardent Deweyite” and wanted to study with Sidney Hook, “the high priest of pragmatism.” His master’s thesis is titled Dewey and the Paradox of the Alleged Futurity of Yesterday. However, he wrote a paper for visiting professor Anthony Flew on McTaggart’s views on time and made a “decisive turn to ordinary language philosophy.” This began his passion for the problem of time that never left him.

He wrote term papers on Aristotle’s theory of time, Kant’s theory of time, Husserl’s theory of time, and so forth, one after another in every subsequent course. He wrote his Ph.D. thesis, The Concept of Time in 20th Century Analytic Philosophy, under Milton Munitz, “a saintly man whose egoless love of philosophy was inspiring.”

Gale entered the job market in January of 1961 and discovered that he had a peculiar knack for “blowing” job interviews because his aggressive quality “scared people.” In a panic, he changed strategy and took his wife Maya along to an interview at Vassar. He was offered the job. According to Gale, the better part of his success in life can be credited to Maya. His major accomplishment was “marrying a woman who was a much better person than I.” After meeting her at a party in New York City in 1957 while still in the music business she became “my moral and spiritual vitamin pills, the centre of gravity for my life.” In the acknowledgments in The Divided Self of William James he profusely thanks Maya for her strength, courage, loyalty, spirituality, and sweetness, and adds “in the most heartfelt words I ever wrote [that it] is no accident that animals and birds are attracted to her. They know something.” With his relationship with his wife on a firm footing it was no surprise when children began appearing in quick succession. Andrew was born in 1961, Laurence in 1963, and Julia in 1965.

Soon after becoming an instructor at Vassar, Gale wanted to relocate. Although the students were good and his colleagues “pleasant enough” he needed to get to a top department where his colleagues and graduate students “would beat on me and from whom I could learn.” “I had to publish my way out of Vassar” because Vassar was filled with great teachers “who thought that if you published it proved you didn’t love your students.”

Eventually Gale received offers from Santa Barbara and Pittsburgh. His reaction to Pittsburgh was: “love at first sight.” Pittsburgh was “the space-time capital of the world.” In addition to praising the distinguished Pitt faculty he describes how the “hot shots” among the graduate students “put the fear of God in me”—high praise indeed since God himself had failed to do so. Pitt’s philosophy “hot shots” engendered “panic attacks” on his way to his graduate classes. He audited Sellars’ courses and describes Sellars as “the master tease”. A typical Sellars undergraduate lecture would consist of about thirty minutes of brilliant discussions of the history of ideas, followed by about twenty minutes of criticisms of someone’s views, but when it came time deliver the goods the “bell would ring” and Sellars “would issue a promissory note that never got cashed.” Gale remarks that Sellars, “like the Shadow” had “the ability to cloud men’s minds and make them see what he wanted them to see”—reminiscent of the criticisms Nietzsche levelled at Socrates. Gale later audited classes by Hempel, Salmon, Glymour, Earman, and numerous international visitors at Pitt’s world-famous Centre for the Philosophy of Science. Gale opines that he received “the equivalent of a second Ph.D. in philosophy” at Pitt.

Although Gale had not had any personal interest in religion since his youth, he became interested in the philosophy of religion through his teaching assignments. For, he loved to argue and “no area is more loaded with foxy arguments than the philosophy of religion.” Gale made it his vocation to be the “fly in the ointment” of the analytically-oriented contemporary defenders of theism, Plantinga, Alston, Adams, and Swinburne. It therefore came as a surprise to him when he came up with a new version of the cosmological argument for God’s existence, which he believed works, “sort of”.

Gale called his friend Adolf, “an atheist’s atheist,” and laid out his new argument. “What’s the catch?,” Adolf asked, and Gale answered “There isn’t any: It works.” After a long silence Adolf asked, “Why did you do it, Richard?” Even though Gale passionately defended his new cosmological argument, he remained a non-believer: “Philosophy has never entered into his personal life.” When asked if he is an atheist, agnostic, or theist, he replied, “None of the above.” “If one needs to ask what is the meaning and purpose of life … one has lost one’s way”. “The examined life isn’t worth living”. “The value of doing philosophy professionally is that it enables one to live unphilosophically.”

Gale’s reservations about the value of philosophy were not simple anti-intellectualism. In response to those who feel that being a good person requires that one engage in philosophical reflections on what sorts of reasons should guide one’s life, Gale replied that he is “incapable of that kind of self-reflection. The one thing that “always shall be and always should be a mystery to us is ourselves”—once again, reminiscent of remarks by Nietzsche. Gale admitted one exception to keeping philosophy out of his personal life. He reported telling his friend Alexander Pruss that his defence of his cosmological argument is the first time he became personally involved in a philosophical argument, to which Pruss replied this is because that is his only argument with a true conclusion.

Richard Gale was a great teacher and a warm and caring person, helpful to students and colleagues, always ready to talk philosophy, and possessed of a wicked sense of humour that brought much levity into the world. After a remarkably varied and satisfying life, Gale passed away in his sleep on July 19, 2015 in Knoxville, Tennessee.

2. The Philosophy of Time

Richard Gale published his widely used anthology, The Philosophy of Time with Anchor in 1967. He recalls requesting that a picture of “the river of time be put on the cover” with an “observer on the bridge shining [a] spotlight of presentness onto the water, illuminating one of the events in [their] history floating on the river’s surface” and was “floored” by the “brilliantly astute” question from Anchor’s art department: “What age should the observer be?” This, Gale remarks, discloses the way in which the observer on the bridge has to be “a transcendent spook, similar to Vonnegut’s [timeless] Tralfamadorians.” Gale asked whether Anchor could put a Picasso-like multi-dimensional depiction of the observer to capture the observer at every age in their life. Anchor declined but put a picture of a pocket watch reflected in several mirrors on the cover, illustrating the difficulty in obtaining a non-paradoxical portrait of the observer’s perspective on their own temporal history.

The distinction between the A and B theories of time was first made by McTaggert in 1908. In 1968 Gale published The Language of Time in which he gives an “impassioned defence” of the A-Theory of time. The competing B-theory is the view that time is nothing but a temporal series of events running from earlier to later, where the distinctions between past, present and future are reducible to temporal relations between the events that are in time. Gale’s A-Theory holds that tense-distinctions are irreducible. B-Theorists typically reply that if tensed distinctions are irreducible it is because they are subjective. It is, however, worth noting that later B-theorists, such as Mellor and Smart, admit that the translation of A-sentences into B-sentences often doesn’t succeed, but hold that one can explain the truth conditions of any tensed declarative sentence without appeal to tensed facts, and then use Occam’s razor to get rid of the offending tensed sentences. See “Are There Essentially Tensed Facts?”

B-Theorists often argue for the subject-dependency of the “now” or the present, and thus of the past and future, by an analogy between the “now” and the “here”. B-theorists argue that since everyone admits that there is not an objective “here” (everywhere can be “here” to someone), and since the logic of “now” is analogous to the logic of “here”, the “now” is as subjective as the “here”. Gale replies that there are deep disanalogies between the “now” and the “here” that suggest that the “now” is objective in a way that the “here” is not because our temporal perspectives are “imposed on us” in a way that our spatial perspectives are not. S, currently in Pittsburgh, calls Pittsburgh “here,” but could easily hop a plane to Singapore, whereupon Singapore would be “here,” and then, hop another plane back to Pittsburgh whereupon Pittsburgh would again be “here.” By contrast, S, in 2016, cannot hop into a device that transports S to 100 B.C. and then return via the device, to 2016 again.

Gale (1964c) argues that agential-based asymmetries between the past and the future are rooted in our concept of causation for which there are no spatial analogies. We can bring about events in the future but not the past. S, currently in Pittsburgh, can, theoretically, causally impact events at any point in space, for example, in Singapore, but cannot causally impact events that happened in 100 B.C. Space and time, from the perspective of the causal-agent, are just different.

Gale stresses that he is not arguing for the objective reality of a “queer” entity, the present or the “now”—which is disclosed by that transcendent spotlight of presentness on the River of Time. That “queer” view of temporal becoming leads to a contradiction. Rather, “The present” and the “now” are rigid designators: The proposition expressed by “Now might not be now” is necessarily false. However, if some time passes, and the present shifts to a later time, “then now will not be now – this very moment of time – at some later time, in violation of the necessity of identity between individuals designated by rigid designators.” As Gale puts it, “entiative theories about the present”, theories that see time as some queer sort of entity, confuse “the what with the how of reference.” There is nothing mysterious about what is denoted by a use of “now”. If Sue tells her partner “now’s the time,” no one need consult a philosopher about what is meant. What is mysterious is the how in such references because “we are prisoners of time [with] a unique temporal perspective … imposed upon us.”

Finally, Gale discusses the disagreement between the A- and B-theorists regarding whether there is “a bifurcation between man and nature.” Smart and Grünbaum argue that science abstracts from personal indexical expressions because they are subjective and not needed for a complete objective description of the world. It is not important to science that someone is now rolling balls down inclined planes with certain results. It is only important that at some time t1 certain balls were rolled down an inclined plane with certain results. Gale calls this the “error theory of tensed temporal perspectives”. Presupposing his views about the objective disanalogies between spatial and temporal indexical expressions, Gale rejects this as a “scientistic” bias that needs only to be stated clearly to be refuted.

3. Negation and Non-Being

Gale believes that his critique of B-theories of time prepared him for his next major interest in negation and non-being. Just as the early B-Theorists of time attempt to translate all A-propositions into B-propositions, some philosophers aspire to translate all negative statements into positive ones (to eliminate irreducibly negative truths about the world). Gale attempts to escape this reduction by devising adequate criteria for the legitimate use of negative propositions. Gale (1970a) argues that otherness and incompatibility analyses fail to reduce negative to positive propositions. One cannot analyse “This is not green” into the conjunction of “Every positive property of this is other than greenness” and “There is some positive property of this that is incompatible with greenness.”

Although Gale believes that the attempt to reduce negative propositions to positive incompatibility propositions fails, he does credit it with helping to demystify negative facts and events. The problem with negative facts is that we do not possess adequate identity-conditions for them. There is no non-arbitrary criterion for answering questions like “How many forest fires did not occur yesterday?” Even though Gale rejects the attempt to reduce negative to positive propositions he (1972) admits that incompatibility and otherness analyses do give useful extensional criteria of identity for negative events which satisfy Parmenides’ injunction against referring to that which is not (because these sorts of analyses only quantify over positive properties and existent individuals). If asked how many forest fires did not occur yesterday one can reply, “One did not occur in the Allegheny National forest, another did not occur in the Mendocino National Forest, another did not occur …, and so on” (where the “and so on” is not problematic because it only alludes to existing forests).

4. The Philosophy of Religion

a. The Nature and Existence of God

Although it may seem that analytical philosophy is inherently antithetical to religious belief (1991a, 2), a new breed of analytically-oriented philosophers, notably Plantinga, Alston, Adams, and Swinburne, has emerged to defend the rationality of theism—the view that an omnipotent, omniscient, and omnibenevolent creator of the world exists. Gale’s On the Nature and Existence of God is the fruit of his aim to be the “fly in the ointment” of these analytical theists. Gale’s project is positive in that it aims to improve the theistic concept of God. It is negative in that it argues that the grounds for theism are often shaky (1991a, 2-3). The spirit of Hume’s Philo imbues the book (1991a, 2). Gale does not pretend to answer the question of God’s existence because he does not consider arguments from beauty or design (1991a, 1). The first part of the book, “Atheological Arguments,” considers arguments that attempt to show that there is a logical inconsistency in the theist’s concept of God (1991a, 15). “Blasphemy aside,” this part of the book helps one “redesign” the concept of God (1991a, 3-4). The second part, “Theological Arguments,” critically examines the main traditional arguments for theism. Gale divides these into the epistemological arguments, the ontological argument, the cosmological argument, and the argument from religious experience, and “prudential arguments,” the latter of which purport to establish the prudential or moral benefits of believing in the theist’s God. Gale is primarily concerned with the former and only deals with prudential arguments in Chap. 9 (1991a, 3).

Since the sort of “historical-cum-indexical” account often given for fixing the reference of ordinary proper names does not work for supernatural beings, and since different theists have widely divergent views about their God, Gale, in the introduction, attempts to show how “we” and Abraham can refer to the same God (1991a, 4-10). Gale’s positive account, which does not imply that God exists, distinguishes between “hard” and “soft core” features of God (1991a, 7). A hard core feature, which is important in determining reference, is one without which God could not be God (1991a, 10). Soft core features can be abandoned without change of reference. Absolute simplicity is given as an example of a soft core feature and being supremely great as a hard core feature (1991a, 8). The hard core features are high level “emergent” properties, for example, that God is eminently worthy of worship is an “emergent” property that supervenes on God’s lower-level properties of omnipotence, omniscience, and so forth. Gale does not provide an account of this kind of emergence, claiming that the emergence-connection is “loose” (1991a, 8). Gale’s positive account of how “we” fix the reference of “God” involves both an historical-causal theory and the requirement that the co-referring speakers share the same form of religious life (1991a, 9-10). What counts as the same religious community over time is “a deep issue” that Gale does not pretend to solve (1991a, 10-11).

Chap. 3 deals with “The Omniscience-Immutability Argument.” That is, if God is omniscient He must know everything. That means that He must know temporal facts in the A-series (involving irreducible indexical expressions like “It is now 3 PM”). However, if God is not in time, He cannot know A-series facts because He has no “now” to know (1991a, 58). But if He is in time then He is not immutable. For if He knows what is now true then what is true of Him differs from moment to moment. Gale considers whether one might escape this dilemma by restricting God’s omniscience to B-series facts (A-series facts being beneath His timeless knowledge) (1991a, 60). However, it is religiously important for God to know A-series facts (1991a, 72-73), for example, for God to know that Abraham is now preparing to sacrifice Isaac. Gale concludes that one must eliminate timelessness and immutability from the concept of God (1991a, 95-97).

Chap. 4, the longest chapter in the book, discusses the deductive problem of evil. Gale argues that Mackie’s arguments either fail or depend on disputable premises. He reformulates this as the problem of what “morally exonerating excuses” God might have to allow evil in the world (1991a, 32, 105). If no morally exonerating reasons are found then one concludes on inductive grounds that theism is incompatible with the existence of evil. If, however, theists can show that God has morally exonerating reasons for allowing evil then theism is consistent with the existence of evil. Plantinga’s version of the “free will defence,” the view that the existence of free will outweighs the evil produced by free will, “is a thing of beauty.” (1991a, 113) Plantinga’s key claim is that it is logically possible that a maximally perfect God is not able to create a world in which there are persons that are free to do good or evil but that always do the good. Since a world with free persons who do more good than evil is better than any world without free persons it seems reasonable to infer that it is logically possible that God has a morally exonerating excuse for permitting evil by creating such a world. Gale rejects most of the common objections to Plantinga’s free-will defence. However, Gale argues that Plantinga’s free-will defence eliminates human freedom and makes God not only responsible for people’s evil deeds but morally blameworthy for them.

First, Gale argues that Plantinga’s free will defence makes God the cause (in the sense of moral responsibility and blame) of the actions of those created free persons. Since God knows that S will freely do evil then, in creating S, God is both responsible and blameworthy for the evil that S does (1991a, 153-156). Second, Gale argues that since Plantinga’s God has “middle knowledge” of His created human beings, that is, knowledge of what possible things would do in different circumstances (NEG, 131), they are not really acting freely (1991a, 133). God does not merely know that possible person J is constructed in a certain way. God knows that if J is put in a certain circumstance C then J will behave in a certain way W. Gale then urges an analogy between God’s creating J while possessing “middle knowledge” of what J will do in C with cases where someone programs J’s psychological makeup so that J will act in certain way in C. If one induces J, who has an amorous nature, to call Alice for a date by telling J that Alice is interested in him, one does not cancel J’s freedom—one does not drug, hypnotize, or brainwash J (1991a, 157). However, the nature of God’s control over his created beings is freedom-cancelling (1991a, 122, 153ff). Gale does not claim this analogical argument is conclusive but only that it casts reasonable doubt on Plantinga’s free-will defence (NEG, 158-160).

In the second Part of the book Gale considers several of the traditional arguments for the rationality of belief. Chap. 6 considers the ontological argument, which comes in two forms, Anselm’s original form and the updated modal version. Since Gale agrees with Plantinga’s critique of Anselm’s argument (2003a), most of his discussion is concerned with Plantinga’s modal argument. Plantinga’s argument requires the premise that there is some possible world that contains a being that necessarily exists and is maximally perfect. Following modal theorem S5 (If it is possible that it is necessary that p then it is necessary that p), Plantinga infers that God necessarily exists. Gale replies that many atheists would not agree that there is some possible world in which a necessarily existing maximally perfect being exists (1991a, 226). Indeed, since accepting that possibility-premise as it is understood in S5, where possibly necessary means necessary, asking the atheist to accept it begs the question.

Chap 8 considers the argument from religious experience. Gale questions whether powerful religious experiences are cognitive and whether they provide evidence for the existence of God (1991a, 286). The argument that religious experiences are cognitive is usually premised on an alleged analogy to sensory experiences (1991a, 316). Gale argues that arguments by Alston, Gutting, Swinburne, and Wainwright fail to show that religious experiences are relevantly analogous to sensory experiences (1991a, 326). Since God does not occupy space and time, there can be no veridical (non-sensory) experience of God, and if an experience is non-veridical it cannot constitute evidence for the existence of its “object.”

The most famous of the “prudential” arguments is Pascal’s wager. First, “Pascal’s wager” is not really a wager (1991a, 353). If God exists and one bets wrong, one does not lose one’s earthly life. Gale also raises the “many Gods” objection against Pascal. That is, formulations of the “wager” presuppose that either there is a God who rewards believers with infinite bliss or there is no God at all. However, many kinds of God are possible. Imagine a God who rewards people who step on every third sidewalk crack and condemns those who do not to infinite punishment (1991a, 350). The logic of the “wager” gives one as much reason to believe in this bizarre God as it does to believe in the theist’s God.

Gale argues against James’ “Will to Believe” argument, claiming that James fails to show that one can have sufficient moral reasons for “self-inducing an epistemically unsupported belief” (1991a, 283). Rather, to believe propositions unsupported by evidence violates one’s duty as a rational person and undermines one’s own personhood (1991a, 372, 376, 382-383).

b. The Gale-Pruss Cosmological Argument

Gale (1999c) published a new modal version of the cosmological argument. Gale and his former student, Alexander Pruss, jointly published a simplified and strengthened modal version of the argument (hereafter GP) titled “A New Cosmological Argument.” GP does not purport to prove the existence of Anselm’s God but does purport to prove that “there [necessarily] exists in the actual world a very powerful and intelligent supernatural designer-creator of this world’s universe.” Call this being, similar but not identical to Anselm’s God, “G”. GP also holds that G is a self-explaining being in the sense that there is a successful ontological argument for its existence, even if one is not able to provide it.

GP presupposes the notion of a possible world. GP also employs the notions of contingent and necessary propositions. Contingent propositions are both possibly true and possibly false (true in some possible worlds and false in others). Necessarily true propositions are true in all possible worlds. GP holds that a possible world is “a maximal, compossible conjunction of abstract propositions”. It is maximal in the sense that for every proposition q, either q or not-q is a conjunct in this conjunction. Every possible world is compossible in the sense that it is conceptually or logically possible that all of the conjuncts in the conjunction that specifies that world can be true together. There are no impossible (contradictory) worlds. There are also possible worlds that have different laws of nature than those in the actual world. Further, GP treats necessary truths as facts. It is a “fact” in the actual world that it is not both raining and not raining (at the same time in the same place).

GP admits that it would be unfair to assume the strong Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSRs) that there is a sufficient explanation for any fact in the world because that is close to assuming that there is a sufficient first cause for these facts, which most opponents of the cosmological argument would reject. GP only asserts a weak version of PSR (PSRw), that it is possible that such facts have an explanation. Opponents of the cosmological argument cannot reasonably deny that a sufficient explanation for such facts is possible. Finally, GP assumes the modal axiom S5 that if it is possible that it is necessary that p then it is necessary that p. For example, since it is possible that 2 + 2 = 4 is necessarily true then, by S5, it is necessarily true that 2 + 2 = 4.

The simplified core of GP is this: (1) If it is possible that a necessary supernatural creator of the actual world, G, exists, then it is necessary that a supernatural creator of the world, G, exists. (2) It is possible that a supernatural creator of the world, G, exists. Therefore, (3) it is necessary that a supernatural creator of the world, G, exists.

The first premise is an instantiation of S5. If one accepts S5, the second premise is the key and most of GP is concerned with the second premise. GP defines the Big Conjunctive Fact (BCF) of a possible world, the maximal compossible conjunction of all propositions that would be true of that world if it were actualized. The BCF of the actual world consists in all the propositions (both necessary and contingent) that are actually true.

Since all possible worlds share the same set of necessary propositions, the distinction between the different possible worlds resides in their different contingent propositions that would be true in those worlds if they were actualized. A contingent proposition (or being) is one that possibly, in a broadly conceptual or logical sense, is true (or existent) and possibly is false (or nonexistent). The Big Conjunctive Contingent Fact (BCCF), which contains the contingent propositions that would be true in a possible world, were it actualized. Since all possible worlds share the same set of necessary propositions, the different possible worlds are individuated by their different BCCF’s. Since every possible world is maximal, then, for every contingent proposition p, either p or not-p is a conjunct in this BCCF. Thus, no two possible worlds can have the same BCCF.

GP calls the BCCF of the actual world “p”. Thus, p includes the existence of and non-existence of all contingent beings in the world and the occurrence and non-occurrence of all contingent events in the actual world, but it also includes all the contingent acts of any necessary beings that may exist in the actual word. GP argues that p has a sufficient explanation in the actual world. Although many philosophers will deny that p does or must have a sufficient explanation, they cannot deny that it is possible that there is some possible world w1 that contains p but also contains q and the proposition that q explains p. But this hypothetical possible world w1 turns out to be identical with w, the actual world. Suppose there were some difference between w and w1. Then, since possible worlds are maximal, there must be some proposition r true in w1 but not true in w. But if r is true in w1 and not in w, then, by the law of the bivalence, ~ r is true in w. Since, however, by hypothesis, everything actually true in w is also true in w1 (because w1 contains p), ~ r is true in w1 as well. But this means that r and ~ r are true in w1, which is a contradiction, and that cannot be, because w1 is supposed to be a possible world. Since the assumption that w1 is a different from w implies a contradiction, it follows that w1 is the same as w. Thus, the actual world w contains q and the proposition that q explains p. Thus, the actual world w contains a sufficient explanation of its p.

What is the nature of this q? GP claims that it is a conceptual truth, of which theonly sorts of explanations it can conceive are scientific and personal explanations. Call this claim SPE. A scientific explanation explains why some proposition is true by reference to some conjunction of law-like propositions and at least one contingent proposition that reports a state of affairs at some time. A personal explanation elucidates why some proposition is true by reference to the intentional action of an agent. GP admits that there might be types of explanation that are beyond our ken, but, “in philosophy we ultimately must go with what we can make intelligible to ourselves ….” One is left with the choice between scientific and personal explanations. But q cannot be a scientific explanation. Since scientific propositions are contingent, this would mean that q is part of w’s BCCF and that would mean that the explanation of w’s BCCF is a part of that BCCF. Since “law-like propositions cannot explain themselves,” q can only, by disjunctive syllogism, be a personal explanation that reports the intentional actions of some being.

However, q cannot report the actions of a contingent being. If it were contingent, the proposition that states its existence would be part of the BCCF of w and, therefore, “q itself is not able to explain why the contingent being it refers to exists, since a contingent being’s intentional action” presupposes “and hence cannot explain, that being’s existence.” Thus, q refers to the intentional actions of a necessary being.

One might assume that q is a necessary proposition because it reports the action of a necessary being. But appearances are deceiving. GP argues that “q is a contingent proposition that reports the free intentional action of a necessary being.” GP most favored argument for the claim that q is a contingent proposition is a reductio based on the assumption that q is necessarily true. If q is necessarily true, then q is a conjunct in the BCF of all possible worlds. Since, however, q entails p (the BCCF of w), and since a possible world is individuated by its BCCF, it follows that every possible world is identical with w, which means that there is only one possible world. Since, despite protests from Spinoza and Leibniz, this is absurd, q is a contingent proposition.

Since G is a necessary being it satisfies one key component of the traditional notion of a theistic God. But some versions of traditional theism, for example, Leibniz, found it hard to account for the apparent contingency in the world. That is, even though Leibniz condescends to call certain propositions “contingent”, he is committed to hold that from God’s point of view (the only truly adequate one) all propositions are necessary (Russell, 1967, 60-61). Thus, Leibniz cannot use GP because there is, for Leibniz, really no such thing as a BCCF. The ingenuity of GP is that it finds genuine roles, which Leibniz could not accept, both for the contingent and the necessary. The genuine contingency in the world rests on the free choices of a necessary G.

Oppy (2000) counters that GP is committed to PSRs. Since accepting PSRw commits the opponents of theism to accepting PSRs, GP is committed to accept the PSRs that it hoped to avoid. Gale and Pruss (2002) accept that that PSRw entails PSRs but hold that though PSRs is entailed by their argument, it is not a premise in their argument. Thus, the only reason opponents of GP have for rejecting PSRw is that it leads to the theistic view that they reject.

Despite the facts that Gale has fiercely defended GP, he remains an “unbeliever”. So “why did you do it Richard?” The answer is that Gale is still the “detached … spectator of all time and eternity” following the logic wherever it leads, even to a proof of God’s existence, in which he is personally uninterested, but which, he believes, works—“well sort of”.

5. Pragmatism

 In the early 1990’s Gale found himself drawn back to his “old flames”, James and Dewey, and “fell madly in love with James again”. Gale’s book, The Divided Self of William James, attempts to formulate James’ ethics based on his “Promethean pragmatism”. James’ Promethean pragmatism consists in three propositions: 1.) We are always morally obligated to maximize desire satisfaction over desire dissatisfaction, 2.) Belief is an action, therefore, 3.) We are always morally obligated to believe in such a manner that maximizes desire satisfaction over desire dissatisfaction (1999a, 11, 25). James’s aim is to ground, not just beliefs, but also meaning, reference, and truth, in ethics. Working from his basic empiricism, James attempts to determine the ontological status of ethical terms by analysing one’s experiential reasons for predicating them, which leads him to reject the Platonic view that the good is determined by the Form of the Good prior to the existence of sentient beings. Gale approvingly quotes James’ remark that “neither moral relations nor the moral law can swing in vacuo” (1999a, 27). Gale argues that one of the reasons for the failure to appreciate James is that Dewey co-opted him for his own ends by naturalizing James’ views, thereby eliminating the mystical and spiritual dimensions that had motivated James (1999a, 335).

Gale’s book, John Dewey’s Quest for Unity, is an attempt to come to terms with his other early love. Gale argues that Dewey attempts to combine Prometheanism with his own unique type of mysticism, but never achieves a successful synthesis. Gale’s Dewey sees human beings as Promethean creators of meaning via action in nature where artistic creation is the paradigm of creative synthesis (but something similar holds for the creation of knowledge and moral action). The problem, according to Gale, is that the remnants of the absolute Idealism from Dewey’s early Hegelianism extend into his mature period (2010a, 163). Though Dewey constantly appeals to experience, he has two notions of experience, one being the ordinary common sense notion of experience that results from the interaction between and organism and its environment, the other being a Plotinian-Hegelian “Absolute, the only true individual, with everything emanating out of it” (2010a, 163).

Before beginning the Dewey-book, Gale feared that he would not be able to write a very positive book on Dewey. Many critics agree, arguing that Gale greatly misunderstands Dewey. Dewey’s problem, Gale holds, is that he tries to ground his grand normative vision in a “misbegotten metaphysics” (2010a,16). Gale admits that his vision of a Hegelian Absolute experience “goes well beyond the letter of [Dewey’s] text” (2010a, 162). Gale replies that he is trying to free Dewey’s view, with which he obviously has some sympathy, from the remnants of an obscure Hegelian metaphysics that distorts Dewey’s potentially very valuable philosophy. Indeed, Gale states that if the greatness of a philosopher consists in the beneficial effects their writings have upon the reader, then “Dewey must be reckoned the greatest philosopher of all time” (2010a, 9).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. Books Edited

  • Gale, Richard, (ed.). The Philosophy of Time New York Anchor Doubleday Books, 1967
    • Gale contributed five ten-page introductions to the five sections of the book.
  • Gale, Richard, (ed.). The Blackwell Companion to Metaphysics Oxford: Blackwell, 2002
  • Gale, Richard, with Pruss, Alexander, ed’s. The Existence of God International Research Library of Philosophy Dartmouth Publishing, 2003
    • This anthology of articles by numerous authors provides a useful companion to Gale’s On the Nature and Existence of God and contains a “mammoth” introduction by Gale and Pruss.

ii. Books Authored

  • Gale, Richard. The Language of Time London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1968
  • Gale’s primary articulation and defence of the A-theory of time against the B-theory
  • Gale, Richard. Negation and Non-being, American Philosophical Quarterly Monograph No. 10. Oxford: Blackwell, 1976
    • Gale claimed that this book fell “stillborn from the presses” because it went un-reviewed but holds that it was at the time the only systematic historical and philosophical discussion of these issues.
  • Gale, Richard. On the Nature and Existence of God London: Cambridge University Press, 1991a
    • Gale’s critical response to a variety of different analytical arguments, both for and against theism
  • Gale, Richard. The Divided Self of William James London: Cambridge University Press, 1999a
    • Considered by many to be Gale’s best book, Gale describes James as a synthesis of ‘Promethean’ Pragmatism, which holds that language and concepts are a means for controlling nature, and a mystic who believes that ultimate reality is inaccessible to conceptualization.
  • Gale, Richard. The Philosophy of William James: an Introduction. London: Cambridge University Press, 2004
    • An accessible introduction to Gale’s view of James
  • Gale, Richard. On the Philosophy of Religion Boston: Wadsworth, 2007.
    • A useful clearly written textbook on central issues in the philosophy of religion
  • Gale, Richard. John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic. Amherst: Prometheus Press, 2010
    • Argues that Dewey’s philosophy is valuable because it attempts, unsuccessfully, to synthesize the Promethean view that human beings are creators of meaning with Dewey’s own brand of mysticism
  • Gale, Richard. God and Metaphysics Amherst: Prometheus Press, 2010
    • A collection of Gale’s seminal articles in the various areas of philosophy, including God, time, non-being, and pragmatism

iii. Articles

  • Gale, Richard. “Russell’s Drill Sergeant, Bricklayer and Dewey’s Logic,” Journal of Philosophy 56 (1959): 401-406
  • Gale, Richard. “Natural Law and Human Rights,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 20 (1960a): 521-531
  • Gale, Richard. “Mysticism and Philosophy,” Journal of Philosophy 57 (1960b): 471-481
  • Gale, Richard. “Endorsing Predictions,” Philosophical Review 70 (1961a): 376-385
  • Gale, Richard. “Professor Ducasse on Determinism,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 22 (1961b): 92-96
  • Gale, Richard. “Tensed Statements,” Philosophical Quarterly 12 (1962a): 53-59
  • Gale, Richard. “Can a Prediction’ Become True’?” Philosophical Studies 13 (1962b): 43-46
  • Gale, Richard. “Dewey and the Problem of the Alleged Futurity of Yesterday,” Philosophical and Phenomenological Research 22 (1962c): 501-511
  • Gale, Richard. “A Reply to Smart, Mayo, and Thalberg on ‘Tensed Statements’,” Philosophical Quarterly 13 (1963a): 351-356.
  • Gale, Richard. “Some Metaphysical Statements about Time,” Journal of Philosophy 60 (1963b): 225-237
    • Argues that the paradox in various metaphysical statements about the unreality of time is revelatory
  • Gale, Richard. “Is It Now Now?” Mind 73 (1964a): 97-105.
    • Attempts to exhibit the three necessary conditions for tensed communication. Argues that the Present and the ‘Now’ are rigid designators and therefore are not subjective
  • Gale, Richard. “A Reply on the ‘Alleged Futurity of Yesterday,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 24 (1964b): 421-422
    • Discusses the question whether there is a paradox in the pragmatist view that the meaning of any statement is the sum-total of experiential consequences that can be found in our experiential future
  • Gale, Richard. “The Egocentric Particular and Token-Reflexive Analyses of Tense,” Philosophical Review 73 (1964c): 213-228
    • Argues against the B-theorist’s view that the seemingly irreducible features of tensed propositions are subjective
  • Gale, Richard. “On Believing What Isn’t the Case,” Proceedings of the XIIIth International Congress of Philosophy (1964d)
  • Gale, Richard, with Douglas McGee and Frank Tillman. 1964. “Ryle on Use, Usage, and Utility,” Philosophical Studies 15 (1964): 57-60
    • Argues that Ryle’s distinction between linguistic use and usage, in order to distinguish the practice of philosophers from that of grammarians and philologists, fails
  • Gale, Richard. “Falsifying Retrodictions,” Analysis 26 (1964e):6-9
    • Disposes of several counterexamples to the view that there is no way for us to act now to falsify retrodictions
  • Gale, Richard, and Irving Thalberg. “The Generality of Predictions,” Journal of Philosophy 62 (1965a): 195-210
    • Argues that there are certain crucial logical asymmetries between past and future that are deeply entrenched in the way we speak about the past and the future
  • Gale, Richard. “Why a Cause Cannot Be Later than Its Effect,” Review of Metaphysics 19 (1965b): 209-234.
  • Gale, Richard. “Existence, Tense, and Presupposition,” The Monist 50 (1966a): 98-108
    • Argues that “exists (existed, will exist)” is not a predicate of things and that “is present (past, future)” is not a predicate of events or states of affairs
  • Gale, Richard. 1966b. “McTaggart’s Analysis of Time,” American Philosophical Quarterly (1966b):145–152
    • Argues for Gale’s A-theory of time
  • Gale, Richard. “Pure and Impure Descriptions,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy (1967a) 45:32–43
  • Gale, Richard. “Propositions, Judgments, Sentences, and Statements,” Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 6, Paul Edwards, (ed.) New York, Macmillan (1967b): 494-505
  • Gale, Richard. “Indexical Signs, Egocentric Particulars and Token-Reflexive Words,” Paul Edwards (ed.). Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 4. New York: Macmillan, 1967c
  • Gale, Richard. “Hook’s Views on Metaphysics,” Sidney Hook and the Contemporary World, Paul Kurtz, (ed.). J. Day Co., 1968
  • Gale, Richard. “’Here’ and ‘Now’,” The Monist 53 (1969a): 396-409
    • Argues that there are certain crucial asymmetries between ‘here’ and ‘now’
  • Gale, Richard. “A Note on Personal Identity and Bodily Continuity,” Analysis 30 (1969b):193-195
  • Gale, Richard. “Do Performative Utterances Have any Constative Function?” Journal of Philosophy 67 (1969c): 117-121
  • Gale, Richard. “Negative Statements,” American Philosophical Quarterly 7 (1970a): 206-217
    • Discusses how to construct a reasonably clear criterion between positive and negative statements
  • Gale, Richard. “Strawson’s Restricted Theory of Referring,” Philosophical Quarterly 20 (1970b): 162-165.
    • Argues that Strawson’s restricted (relative to Russell’s) theory of referring leads to absurdities
  • Gale, Richard. “Has the Present Any Duration?” Noûs 5 (1970c): 39-47
    • Argues that the durational present, which can be interpreted as the punctual present, has, except for the irreducible reference to now, has the same characteristics as the corresponding instant in the B-series
  • Gale, Richard. “The Fictive Use of Language,” Philosophy 46 (1971): 324-340
    • Employs Austin’s trilogy of locutionary, illocutionary, and perlocutionary acts to argue that the difference between fictive and non-fictive uses of language are fundamentally pragmatic
  • Gale, Richard. “On What There Isn’t,” Review of Metaphysics 25 (1972): 459-488
    • Argues that negative facts cannot be reduced to positive ones
  • Gale, Richard. “O’Connor on the Identity of Indiscernibles,” Philosophical Studies 24 (1973a): 412-415
  • Gale, Richard. “Bergson’s Analysis of the Concept of Nothing,” Modern Schoolman 51 (1973b): 269-300
    • Applies Gale’s analyses of negative propositions to the question whether absolute nothingness is possible
  • Gale, Richard. “Could Logical Space Be Empty?” Essays on Wittgenstein in Honor of G.H. von Wright, Jaakko Hintikka and G.H. von Wright, (ed’s). Acta Philosophica Fennica, vol. 28, Thos. 1-2, 1976
    • Explores the question whether in Wittgenstein’s Tractatus all positive atomic propositions could be false
  • Gale, Richard. 1977. “A Reply to Oaklander,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (1977): 234-238.
    • Defends his claim (that there can be a B-series of events only if these events also form an A-series) against Oaklander’s objection to that claim from The Language of Time
  • Gale, Richard. “Wiggins’ Thesis D (x),” Philosophical Studies 45 (1984): 239-245
    • Argues that Wiggins’ principle of Sortal Dependency easily leads to counterexamples
  • Gale, Richard. “William James and the Ethics of Belief,” American Philosophical Quarterly 17 (1985): 1-14
    • Gale describes this paper as an attempt to capture the “spirit and thrust” of James’ The Will to Believe.
  • Gale, Richard. “Omniscience-Immutability Arguments,” American Philosophical Quarterly 23 (1968a): 319-335.
    • Argues for Gale’s A-theory of time
  • Gale, Richard. “A Priori Arguments from God’s Abstractness,” Noûs 20 (1986b): 531-543.
    • Argues that the a priori arguments based on God’s abstractness that God necessarily exists are uncompelling
  • Gale, Richard. “Parfit’s Arguments Against Partially Relativized Theories of Rationality,” Analysis 47 (1986c): 230-236.
  • Gale, Richard. “Freedom vs. Unsurpassable Greatness,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 23 (1988): 65-75.
    • Argues against Plantinga’s new version of the ontological argument
  • Gale, Richard. “Lewis’ Indexical Argument for World-Relative Actuality,” Dialogue 28 (1989): 289-304
  • Gale, Richard. “Freedom and the Free Will Defence,” Social Theory and Practice 16 (1990): 397-423
  • Gale, Richard. “Becoming,” Handbook. Philosophia Verlag, 1991b
  • Gale, Richard. “On Some Pernicious Thought-Experiments,” Thought Experiments in Science and Philosophy, G. Massey and T. Horowtiz, (ed’s). Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 1991c
  • Gale, Richard. “Pragmatism versus Mysticism: The Divided Self of William James,” Philosophical Perspectives, vol. 5, James Tomberlin, (ed.) Atascadero: Ridgeview, 1991d
  • Gale, Richard; Pruss, Alexander. “Cosmological and Design Arguments,” Oxford Handbook of the Philosophy of Religion Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991e
  • Gale, Richard. “Reply to Paul Helm,” Religious Studies 29 (1993): 257-263.
    • Argues that religious experiences are conceptualizable in a way that we do not adequately understand but that they do not provide evidence for the existence of the accusative
  • Gale, Richard. “William James on Self-Identity Over Time,” Modern Schoolman 71 (1994a): 165-189.
  • Gale, Richard. “The Overall Argument of Alston’s Perceiving God,” Religious Studies 30 (1994b): 135-149
    • Argues against Alston’s pragmatic and epistemic arguments that it is rational to believe in God’s existence
  • Gale, Richard. “Swinburne’s Argument from Religious Experience,” Alan G. Padgett (ed.), Reason and the Christian Religion Oxford: Clarendon, 1994c
    • Argues against Swinburne’s argument from religious experience
  • Gale, Richard. “McTaggart, John McTaggart Ellis,” Encyclopedia of Time, Samuel Macey, (ed.) New York: Garland, 1994d
  • Gale, Richard. “Russell, Bertrand Arthur William,” Encyclopedia of Time. Samuel Macey, (ed). New York: Garland, 1994e
  • Gale, Richard. “Analytic Philosophy,” Encyclopedia of Time. Samuel Macey, (ed). New York: Garland, 1994f
  • Gale, Richard. “Why Alston’s Mystical Doxastic Practice is Subjective,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 54 (1994g): 869 – 875.
    • Argues against Alston that alleged direct perceptions of God are subjective and unreliable
  • Gale, Richard. “Non-Being and Nothing,” Oxford Companion to Philosophy, Ted Hondereich, (ed.). Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995
  • Gale, Richard, and Earman, John. “Time,” Cambridge Dictionary of Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995
  • Gale, Richard. “John McTaggart Ellis McTaggart,” A Companion to Metaphysics, J. Kim and E. Sosa, (ed’s.). Blackwell-Wiley, 1996a
  • Gale, Richard. “Negation,” Blackwell’s Companion to Metaphysics, Jaegwon Kim and Ernst Sosa, (ed’s). Hoboken: Blackwell-Wiley, 1996b
  • Gale, Richard. “Nothingness,” Blackwell’s Companion to Metaphysics, Jaegwon Kim and Ernst Sosa, (ed’s). Hoboken: Blackwell-Wiley, 1996c
  • Gale, Richard. “Some Difficulties in Theistic Treatments of Evil,” The Evidential Argument from Evil, Daniel Howard-Snyder, (ed.), (pp. 206-218). Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996d
  • Gale, Richard. “William James’s Quest to Have It All,” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 32 (1996e): 568-596.
  • Gale, Richard. “Disanalogies Between Space and Time,” Process Studies 25 (1996f): 72-89.
    • Argues that there are major disanalogies between space and time and ‘here’ and the ‘now’
  • Gale, Richard. “John Dewey’s Naturalization of William James,” The Cambridge Companion to James, Ruth Anna Putnam, (ed.). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997a
  • Gale, Richard. “William James’s theory of Freedom,” Modern Schoolman 74 (1997b): 227-247.
  • Gale, Richard. “From the Specious to the Suspicious Present: The Jack Horner Phenomenology of William James,” Journal of Speculative Philosophy 11 (1997c): 163-189.
    • Argues that James’ account of how we experience time is based on a faked phenomenology that distorts the way we experience time
  • Gale, Richard. “William James’s Semantics of “Truth’,” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 33 (1997d): 863-898
    • Argues that James’ moralization of epistemology requires him to reject Tarski’s principle that a sentence “s” is true if and only if s and that this means that James’pragmatic theory of meaning can only supply the conditions under which a belief is epistemically warranted
  • Gale, Richard. “William James’ Ethics of Prometheanism,” History of Philosophy Quarterly 15 (1998a): 245-269
  • Gale, Richard. “Ich bin Ein Realist: James’s Attempt to Placate Realism,” International Studies in Philosophy 30 (1998b): 1-17
    • Critically analyses James’ view that we are all morally obligated to maximize desire satisfaction over all other available options
  • Gale, Richard. “Robert M. Adam’s Theodicy of Grace,” Philo 1 (1998c): 36-44.
  • Gale, Richard. “William James and the Willfulness of Belief,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 59 (1999b): 71-91.
    • Argues that there is a salvageable core to James’ view that we can believe at will
  • Gale, Richard. “Santayana’s Bifurcationist Theory of Time,” Bulletin of the Santayana Society (17 (1999c): 1-13
  • Gale, Richard. “A New Argument for the Existence of God: One That Works, Well Sort Of,” The Rationality of Theism: Essays in the Philosophy of Religion. G. Bruntrup & R.K. Tacelli, (ed.)’s. Dordrechet: Kluwer, 1999d
    • Gale’s first statement of his new cosmological argument
  • Gale, Richard, Pruss, Alexander. “A New Cosmological Argument,” Religious Studies 35 (1999): 461-476.
    • Gale’s and Pruss’s improved version of Gale’s new modal cosmological argument
  • Gale, Richard. Introduction to the re-issue of William James and Henri Bergson by Horace Kallen London: Thoemmes Press, 2001
  • Gale, Richard. “Time, Temporality, and Paradox,” Blackwell Guide to Metaphysics, Richard Gale, (ed.). Oxford: Blackwell, 2002a
  • Gale, Richard. “The Metaphysics of John Dewey,” Part I and Part II, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 38 (2002b): 477-519.
    • Explains why Dewey was not the best philosopher of all time but is the best person ever to have been a philosopher.
  • Gale, Richard. “Divine Omniscience, Freedom, and Backward Causation,” Faith and Philosophy 19 (2002c): 85-88.
    • Attempts to deduce a contradiction from the proposition that God is omniscient and immutable and that there are true temporal indexical propositions
  • Gale, Richard. “A Challenge for Interpreters of Varieties,” Streams of William James. The William James Society 4 (2002d): 32-33
  • Gale, Richard. “A Thomist Metaphysics,” Blackwell Guide to Metaphysics. Richard Gale, (ed.) Oxford: Blackwell, 2002e
  • Gale, Richard, Pruss, Alexander. “A Response to Oppy, and to Davey and Clifton,” Religious Studies 38 (2002): 89-99
    • Argues that the fact that the weak principle of sufficient reason entails the strong principle of sufficient reason does not damage their argument and gives one a further reason to accept the weak principle
  • Gale, Richard. “Why Traditional Cosmological Arguments Don’t Work and a Sketch of a New One that Does,” Contemporary Debates in Philosophy of Religion, Michael Peterson, (ed.) Oxford: Blackwell, 2003a
  • Gale, Richard. “God Eternal and Paul Helm,” Reason, Faith and History: Essays in Honour of Paul Helm, Martin Stone, (ed.). London: Ashgate, 2003b
  • Gale, Richard, and Pruss, Alexander. “A Response to Almeida and Judisch,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 53 (2003): 65-72.
    • Denies that their argument leads to a contradiction but acknowledges the need to clarify the nature of their conclusion
  • Gale, Richard. “The Ecumenicalism of William James,” William James and The Varieties of Religious Experience: Centenary Celebration. Jeremy Carrett, (ed.). London: Routledge, 2004a
  • Gale, Richard. “William James and John Dewey: the Odd Couple,” Midwestern Studies in Philosophy 28 (2004b): 149–167.
  • Gale, Richard. “The Still Divided Self of William James: A Response to Pawelski and Cooper Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 40 (2004c): 153-170.
  • Gale, Richard, and Pruss, Alexander. “Cosmological and Teleological Arguments,” Oxford Companion to the Philosophy of Religion, William Wainwright, (ed.), 2005
  • Gale, Richard. “Response to My Critics,” Philo 6 (2003): 132-165
  • Gale, Richard. “John Dewey’s ‘Time and Individuality’,” Modern Schoolman, 82 (2005a): 175-192
  • Gale, Richard. “On the Cognitivity of Mystical Experiences,” Faith and Philosophy 22 (2005b): 426-441
  • Gale, Richard. “Comments on the Will to Believe,” Social Epistemology 20 (2006a): 35-39
  • Gale, Richard. “The Problem of Ineffability in Dewey’s Theory of Inquiry,” Southern Journal of Philosophy 44 (2006b): 75-90.
  • Gale, Richard. “The Failure of Traditional Theistic Arguments,” Cambridge Companion to Atheism, edited by M. Martin, (ed.) Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007a
  • Gale, Richard. “Evil and Alvin Plantinga,” Alvin Plantinga, (ed.) Deane-Peter Baker Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007b
  • Gale, Richard. “Relations,” Encyclopedia of American Philosophy, (ed’s). J. Lachs and R. Talisse. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 2007c
  • Gale, Richard. “Healthy-Mindedness,” Encyclopedia of American Philosophy, (ed’s). J. Lachs and R., Talisse. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 2007d
  • Gale, Richard. “The Influence of William James,” Encyclopedia of American Philosophy, (ed’s). J. Lachs and R. Talisse Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 2007e
  • Gale, Richard. “God,” Encyclopedia of American Philosophy. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 2007f
  • Gale, Richard. “Time,” Encyclopedia of American Philosophy. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 2007g
  • Gale, Richard. “Timothy Sprigge: The Grinch that Stole Time”, Consciousness, Reality and Value: Essays in Honour of T.L.S. Sprigge. Pierfrancesco Basile & Leemon B. McHenry (eds.). Frankfurt: Ontos Verlag, 2007h
  • Gale, Richard. “The Deconstruction of Traditional Philosophy by William James,” Pragmatism,” Looking Toward Last Things: Pragmatism 100 Years After James’s,” John Stuhr, (ed.). Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2009
  • Gale, Richard. “The Naturalism of John Dewey,” Cambridge Companion to John Dewey, (ed.) Molly Cochoran, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010
  • Gale, Richard. “The Problem of Evil,” Routledge Companion to the Philosophy of Religion, (ed’s), Chad Meister and Paul Copan, (ed’s). London: Routledge, 2012
  • Gale, Richard. “James,” Twentieth-Century Philosophy of Religion: The History of Western Philosophy of Religion. New York: Routledge, 2013
  • Gale, Richard. “Autobiography” (unpublished)

iv. Book Reviews

  • Gale, Richard. What Is Political Philosophy? by Leo Strauss Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1961
  • Gale, Richard. The Natural Philosophy of Time by G. J. Whitrow Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1961
  • Gale, Richard. Time and the Physical World by Richard Schlegel Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1963
  • Gale, Richard. Analytical Philosophy of History by Arthur Danto Foundations of Language, 1968
  • Gale, Richard. Essays on Wittgenstein’s Tractatus by Irving Copi and Robert Beard, (ed’s). Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1968
  • Gale, Richard. Joint review of “The Problem of Future Contingencies” by Richard Taylor and “Present Truth and Future Contingency” by Rogers Albritton Journal of Symbolic Logic, 1969
  • Gale, Richard. Kant’s theory of Time by Al-Azum, Studies in History and Philosophy of Science, 1971
  • Gale, Richard. Remarks on Colours by Ludwig Wittgenstein, Review of Metaphysics, 1981
  • Gale, Richard. Time: A Philosophical Analysis by T. Chapman. Dialogue 23 (1984): 153
  • Gale, Richard. Eternity, Internal Studies in Philosophy by Brian Leftow, 1995
  • Gale, Richard. The Correspondence of William James, v. 4, Ignal Skrupskelis, (ed.), Transactions of the Charles Sanders Peirce Society, 1996
  • Gale, Richard. Judaism and the Doctrine of Creation by Norbert Samuelson CCAR Journal: A Reform Jewish Quarterly, 1999
  • Gale, Richard. Heaven’s Champion by Ellen Suckiel Journal of Value Inquiry, 1999
  • Gale, Richard. William James and the Metaphysics of Experience by David Lamberth Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 2000
  • Gale, Richard. Questions of Time and Tense by Robin Le Poidevin, (ed.). Philosophical Books, 2000
  • Gale, Richard. Dewey’s Empirical Theory of Knowledge and Reality by John Shook Transactions of the Charles Sanders Peirce Society, 2001
  • Gale, Richard. Truth, Rationality, and Pragmatism: Themes from Peirce by Christopher Hookway. Philosophical Quarterly, 2001
  • Gale, Richard. A. J. Ayer: A Life by Ben Rogers. Free Inquiry, 2003
  • Gale, Richard. The Unknown God by Antony Kenny Religious Studies, 2004
  • Gale, Richard. God and Philosophy by Antony Flew. Transactions of the Charles Sanders Peirce Society, 2005
  • Gale, Richard. God, the Best, and Evil by Richard Langtry Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews: An Electronic Journal, 2009
  • Gale, Richard. William James at the Boundaries: Philosophy, Science, and the Geography of Knowledge by Franchesca Bordogna Journal of the History of Philosophy 48 (2010): 252-253

v. Critical Studies

  • Gale, Richard. Studies in Metaphilosophy by Morris Lazerowtiz Philosophical Quarterly, 1965
  • Gale, Richard. Referring by Leonard Linsky Journal of Philosophy, 1969
  • Gale, Richard. The Philosophy of Space and Time by Richard Swinburne Journal of Philosophy, 1969
  • Gale, Richard. The Cement of the Universe by J.L. Mackie Modern Schoolman, 1976
  • Gale, Richard. The Concept of Identity by Eli Hirsch Journal of Philosophy, 1983
  • Gale, Richard. The Epistemology of Religious Experience by Keith Yandell Faith and Philosophy, 1995
  • Gale, Richard. Ontological Arguments by Graham Oppy Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 58 (1999): 715-19
  • Gale, Richard, and Pruss Alexander Atheism and Theism by J. J. C. Smart and John Haldane Faith and Philosophy 16 (1999): 106-113
  • Gale, Richard. 1999. Providence and the Problem of Evil by Richard Swinburne, Religious Studies 36 (2):209-219

b. Secondary Sources

  • Scott Aikin. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 46 (2010): 656-659
  • Alston, William. Review of On the Existence and Nature of God by Richard Gale. The Philosophical Review 102 (1993): 433-435
  • Alston, William. Perceiving God: The Epistemology of Religious Experience. Ithaca: Cornell, 2014
  • Beilby, James “Plantinga’s Model of Warranted Christian Belief,” Alvin Plantinga. Deane-Peter Baker, (ed.) Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007
  • Bird, Graham. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. MIND 111 (2002): 100-103
  • Boyle, Deborah. “William James’s Ethical Symphony,” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, 34 (1998): 977-1003
  • Butler, Clark. “Motion and Objective Contradictions,” American Philosophical Quarterly 19 (1981): 131-139
  • Cocchiarella, Nino. Review of The Language of Time by Richard Gale. Journal of Symbolic Logic 37 (1972): 170-172
  • Craig, W.L. “Divine Timelessness and Personhood,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 43 (1998): 109-124
  • Craig, W.L. Time and Eternity. Wheaton, Illinois: Crossway Books, 2001
  • Craig, W.L. The Tensed Theory of Time: A Critical Examination. New York: Springer, 2000
  • Craig, W.L. The Tenseless Theory of Time: A Critical Examination. New York: Springer, 2013
  • Davey, Kevin, Clifton, Robb. “Insufficient Reason in the ‘New Cosmological Argument,” Religious Studies 37 (2001): 485-490
  • Dowden, Bradley. “Time” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy URL: https://iep.utm.edu/time/#SH9e
  • Dyke, Heather. Review of Blackwell Guide to Metaphysics by Richard Gale, (ed.) Australasian Journal of Philosophy 81 (2003): 620-621
  • Evans, Charles. “Timeless Truth,” The Philosophical Review 71 (1962): 241-242
  • Ford. Lewis. “The Duration of the Present,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 35 (1974): 100-106
  • Franks, Christopher. “Passion and the Will to Believe,” The Journal of Religion 84 (2000): 431-449
  • Gellman, Jerome, 2000. “Prospects for a sound stage 3 of cosmological arguments,” The Existence of God, Richard Gale and Alexander Pruss, (ed’s). Farhnam, UK: Ashgate
  • Goldman, Loren. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unuty: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. Education and Culture 29 (2013): 135-139
  • Goodman, Russell B. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Religious Studies 36 (2000): 227-245
  • Helm, Paul. “Gale on God,” Religious Studies 29 (1993): 245-255
  • Hobbs, Charles. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. The Journal of Speculative Philosophy (25 (2011): 28-430
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel, (ed.). The Evidential Argument from Evil Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996
  • Humber, James. “Response to Gale,” Social Theory and Practice: Proceedings from the Georgia State University Conference on Human Freedom 16 (1990): 425-433
  • Iannone, Pablo. Review of The Philosophy of William James: An Introduction by Richard Gale. Review of Metaphysics 59 (2005): 173-174
  • King-Farlow, John. “The Positive McTaggart on Time,” Philosophy 49 (1974): 169-178
  • Khatchadourian, Haig. “Do Ordinary Spatial and Temporal Expressions Designate Relations?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 34 (1973): 82-94
  • Lamberth, David C. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Journal of the American Academy of Religion 68 (2000): 890-893
  • Leftow, Brian. “Time, Actuality and Omniscience,” Religious Studies 26 (1990): 303-321
  • McDonough, Richard. “The Gale–Pruss cosmological argument: Tractarian and advaita Hindu objections,” Religious Studies, 2016. http://journals.cambridge.org/abstract_S0034412516000123.
  • McHugh, Christoper. “A Refutation of Gale’s Creation-Immutability Arguments,” Philo 6 (2003): 5-9
  • McTaggert, J.M.E. “The Unreality of Time,” Mind 17 (1908): 457-474
  • Mellor, D. H., Matters of Metaphysics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991
  • Meyers, Gerald. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 64 (2002): 491-494
  • Meyers, William, and Pappas, Gregory. “Dewey’s Metaphysics: A Response to Richard Gale,” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 40 (2004): 679-700
    • Argues that Gale’s analytical outlook leads him to fundamentally misunderstand Dewey’s philosophy
  • “Moe Gale Dies” Sept. 3, 1964. New York Times
  • Newton-Smith, W. Review of The Language of Time by Richard Gale. The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 20 (1969): 281-283
  • Oaklander, L. Nathan. 1977. “The Timelessness of Time,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 38 (1977): 228-233
    • Argues that Gale’s purported reduction of B-relations to A-determinations fails because it cannot account for the timelessness of time
  • Oaklander, L. Nathan, and Smith, Quentin. The New Theory of Time. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1994
    • An excellent anthology on the philosophy of time that includes interesting discussion both of the older snd the newer versions of the A and B theories of time.
  • Oppy, Graham. Ontological Arguments and Belief in God Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995
  • Oppy, Graham. “On ‘A New Cosmological Argument,’” Religious Studies 36 (2000): 345–353
    • Argues that Gale’s and Pruss’s weak principle of reason entails the strong version of the principle of sufficient reason
  • Oppy, Graham. Arguing about Gods Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006
  • Oppy, Graham. Describing Gods: An Investigation of Divine Attributes Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2014
  • O’Connor, David. God and Inscrutable Evil: In Defence of Theism and Atheism. Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield, 1996
  • Padgett, Alan. “God and Time: Toward a New Doctrine of Divine Timeless Eternity,” Religious Studies 25 (1989): 209-215
  • Pawelski, James. “William James’ Divided Self and the Process of its Unification: A Reply to Richard Gale.” Transactions of the Charles Sanders Peirce Society 39 (2003): 645-656
    • Argues that Gale’s view that James is a mystic and that this produces a self that is divided from its pragmatism is wrong
  • Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief New York: Oxford University Press, 2000
  • Plumer, Gilbert. “Detecting Temporalities,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 47 (1987): 451-460
  • Post, John F. Review of On the Nature and Existence of God by Richard Gale. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 53 (1993): 950-954
  • Plecha, James. “Tenselessness and the Absolute Present,” Philosophy 59 (1984): 529-534
    • Argues contra Gale that one can acknowledge that language can be detensed while accepting the absolute present and rejecting the block universe
  • Prior, A.N. Review of The Language of Time by Richard Gale. Mind 78 (1969): 453
  • Pruss, Alexander. “The Hume-Edwards Principle and the Cosmological Argument,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 43 (1998): 149-165
  • Pruss, Alexander. “A Restricted Principle of Sufficient Reason and the Cosmological Argument,”
  • Religious Studies 40 (2004): 165-179
  • Pruss, Alexander. The Principle of Sufficient Reason: A Reassessment Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010
  • Pruss, Alexander. Actuality, Possibility and Worlds London: Bloomsbury Academic, 2011
  • Rankin, K.W. Review of The Language of Time by Richard Gale. The Philosophical Quarterly 19 (1969): 176-177
  • Raposa, Michael. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. American Journal of Theology & Philosophy 31 (2010): 275-278
  • Reichenbach, Bruce R. The Cosmological Argument: A Reassessment Springfield, Illinois: Charles C. Thomas, 1972
  • Robison, John. “A Note on ‘Falsifying Retrodictions’,” Analysis 26 (1965): 9-11
  • Rowe, William. Review of On The Nature and Existence of God by Richard Gale. Journal of the American Academy of Religion 63 (1995): 592-595
  • Rutten, Emmanuel. A Critical Assessment of Contemporary Cosmological Arguments: Towards a Renewed Case for Theism. Doctoral Thesis: Vrije University. Amsterdam, 2012
  • Saka, Paul. “Pascal’s Wager and the Many Gods Objection,” Religious Studies 37 (2001): 321-341
  • Sanford, David H. “McTaggart on Time,” Philosophy 43 (1968): 371-378
  • Schellenberg, J. L. Review of On the Nature and Existence of God by Richard Gale Review of Metaphysics 46 (1992): 402-404
  • Schlesinger, George. “The Stillness of Time and Philosophical Equanimity,” Philosophical Studies: An International Journal for Philosophy in the Analytic Tradition 30 (1976): 145-159
  • Schlesinger, George. “The Reduction of B-Statements,” Philosophical Quarterly 28 (1978): 162-165
  • Schlesinger, George. Aspects of Time Indianapolis: Hackett, 1980
  • Sherry, Patrick. Review of On the Nature and Existence of God by Richard Gale. Philosophy 67 (1992): 563
  • Shook, John. Review of The Philosophy of William James: An Introduction by Richard Gale. Philosophy in Review 25 (2005): 179-181
  • Slattery, Michael. “More on what there Isn’t,” Review of Metaphysics 26 (1972): 344-348
  • Smart, J.J.C. “Tensed Statements: A Comment,” Philosophical Quarterly 12 (1962): 264-265
  • Smith, Quentin. “The Co-Reporting Theory of Tensed and Tenseless Sentences,” Philosophical Quarterly 40 (1990): 213-222
  • Smith, Quentin. “Sentences about Time,” Philosophical Quarterly 37 (1987): 37-53
  • Stein, Howard. Review of The Language of Time by Richard Gale. Journal of Philosophy 66 (1969): 350-355
  • Stephens, Matthew. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Philosophy in Review 21 (2001): 113-115
  • Suckiel, Ellen Kappy. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 36 (2000): 161-168
  • Suckiel, Ellen Kappy. “The Authoritativeness of Mystical Experience: An Innovative Proposal from William James,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 52 (2002): 175-189
  • Swineburn, Richard. “Reply to Richard Gale,” Religious Studies 36 (2002): 221-225
    • Swineburn responds to Gale’s criticism that his thesis is ambiguous and makes clear that he intends a strong version of the thesis that God is justified in allowing evil to occur.
  • Swineburn, Richard. Review of On the Nature and Existence of God by Richard Gale. The Journal of Theological Studies, NEW SERIES 43 (1992): 784-788
  • Talisse, Robert. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. Philosophical Quarterly 61 (2011): 863-864
  • Tiles, J.E. 2010. Review of John Dewey’s Quest for Unity: The Journey of a Promethean Mystic by Richard Gale. Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews 5 (2010)
  • Tooley, Michael. Time, Tense and Causation Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1997
  • Van Inwagen, Peter. “Reflections on the Chapters by Draper, Russell, and Gale,” The Evidential Argument from Evil, Daniel Howard Snyder, (ed.), Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996
  • Watson, Justin. Review of The Divided Self of William James by Richard Gale. Religion & Literature 31(1999): 124-126
  • White, David A. “Can Alston Withstand the Gale?” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 39 (1996): 141-149
    • Argues that Gale’s argument that God is not the sort of being that can be pinned down and baptised in an act of naming is wrong.
  • Williams, Clifford. “The Metaphysics of A- and B- Time,” Philosophical Quarterly 46 (1996): 371-381
    • Argues that the alleged difference between A- and B- time remains undescribed
  • Williams, Clifford. “Bergsonian Approach to A- and B- Time,” Philosophy 73 (1998): 379-393
  • Zimmerman, Dean. “Richard Gale and the Free Will Defence,” Philo 6 (2003): 78-113

 

Author Information

Richard McDonough
Email: rmm249@cornell.edu
Arium School of Arts & Sciences
Singapore