Francis Hutcheson (1694—1745)

Francis Hutcheson was an eighteenth-century Scottish philosopher whose meticulous writings and activities influenced life in Scotland, Great Britain, Europe, and even the newly formed North American colonies. For historians and political scientists, the emphasis has been on his theories of liberalism and political rights; for philosophers and psychologists, Hutcheson’s importance comes from his theories of human nature, which include an account of an innate care and concern for others and of the internal senses (including the moral sense). The latter were pivotal to the Scottish Enlightenment’s empirical aesthetics, and all of Hutcheson’s theories were important to moral sentimentalism. One cannot properly study the works of Adam Smith, Hutcheson’s most famous student, or David Hume’s moral and political theories, without first understanding Hutcheson’s contributions and influence.

Popular and well-read in his day, Hutcheson’s writings seem to be enjoying resurgence specifically among libertarians, contemporary moral psychologists and philosophers. The latter are taking another and more in-depth look at Hutcheson and the rest of the sentimentalists because present-day empirical studies seem to support many of their claims about human nature. This is not surprising because the philosophical theories of the Scottish Enlightenment were based on human observations and experiences, much of which would be considered psychology today.

As part of his attempt to defend Shaftesbury against the attacks of Bernard Mandeville, Hutcheson’s writings concentrate on human nature. Hutcheson also promoted a natural benevolence against the egoism of Thomas Hobbes and against the reward/punishment view of Samuel Pufendorf by appealing to our own experiences of ourselves and others.

What follows is an overview of Hutcheson’s life, works and influence, with special attention paid to his writings on aesthetics, morality, and the importance of the internal senses of beauty, harmony, and the moral sense.

Life
Internal Senses
Moral Sense Faculty
Benevolence: Response to Hobbes and Pufendorf
Influences on Hume and Smith
References and Further Reading
1. Works by Hutcheson
  1. Collected Works and Correspondence
2. Secondary Readings

1. Life

Francis Hutcheson was born to Scottish parents on August 8, 1694 in Ireland. Though remembered primarily as a philosopher, he was also a Presbyterian minister, as were his father and grandfather before him. After he attended the University of Glasgow in Scotland in 1711 he returned to Dublin in 1716. Rather than taking a ministry position he was asked to start an academy in Dublin, and it was here that he wrote his most influential works. At this time he also married Mary Wilson and had one son, Francis. Eventually he was appointed professor and chair of Moral Philosophy at the University of Glasgow in 1729 following the death of his mentor and teacher, Gershom Carmichael.

Hutcheson was a popular lecturer perhaps because he was the first professor to use English in lectures rather than the commonly used Latin and also, possibly influenced by his preaching experience, was more animated than was typical of an eighteenth-century academic. Throughout his career he retained a commitment to the liberal arts as his thoughts and theories were always connected to the ancient traditions, especially those of Aristotle and Cicero. His writings were respected even before his Glasgow position and this reputation continued throughout his lifetime. His most influential pieces, first published in Dublin anonymously, were An Inquiry into the Original of Our Ideas of Beauty and Virtue (1725) and An Essay on the Nature and Conduct of the Passions and Affections, with Illustrations of the Moral Sense (1728). Hutcheson’s moral theory was influenced most by Lord Shaftesbury, while his aesthetics were in many ways influenced by and a response to John Locke’s primary and secondary qualities. Those who read and were influenced by Hutcheson’s theories included David Hume and Adam Smith, his student at Glasgow, while Thomas Reid and Immanuel Kant both cited Hutcheson in their writings.

Francis Hutcheson died in 1745 after 16 years at Glasgow while on a visit to Ireland, where he is buried. After his death, his son and namesake published another edition of Hutcheson’s Illustrations on the Moral Sense in 1746 and in 1755, A System of Moral Philosophy, a text written specifically for college students.

2. Internal Senses

Though Shaftesbury could be called the father of modern aesthetics, Hutcheson’s thorough treatment of the internal senses, especially of beauty, grandeur, harmony, novelty, order and design in the Inquiry, is what specifically moved the focus of study from rational explanations to the sensations. For Hutcheson the perception of beauty does depend on the external sense of sight; however, the internal sense of beauty operates as an internal or reflex sense. The same is the case with hearing: hearing music does not necessarily give the perception of harmony as it is distinct from the hearing (Inquiry I. I. X). Yet, the internal senses are senses because like the external senses they are immediate perceptions not needing knowledge of cause or advantage to receive the idea of beauty. Both the external and internal senses are characterized by a passive and involuntary nature, and the internal senses are a source of pleasure and pain. With a nod to Locke’s primary and secondary qualities (Inquiry I, 1 7), Hutcheson described perception specifically of beauty and harmony in terms of simple and complex ideas. Without the internal sense of beauty there is no perception of it: “This superior power of perception is justly called a sense, because of its affinity to the other senses in this, that the pleasure does not arise from any knowledge of principles, proportions, causes, or of the usefulness of the object; but strikes us at first with the idea of beauty: nor does the most accurate knowledge increase this pleasure of beauty, however it may super-add a distinct rational pleasure from prospects of advantage, or from the increase of knowledge” (Inquiry I, 1, 8).

The perception of beauty though excited by an object is not possible without this internal sense of beauty. There is a specific type of absolute beauty and there are figures that excite this idea of beauty. We experience this when recognizing what Hutcheson calls “uniformity amidst variety” (Inquiry, I, 2, 3). This happens with both mathematical and natural objects, which although multifaceted and complex, are perceived with a distinct uniformity. The proportions of an animal or human figure can also excite and touch the internal sense as absolute beauty. Imitative beauty, on the other hand, is perceived in comparison to something else or as an imitation in art, poetry, or even in an idea. The comparison is what excites this sense of beauty even when the original being imitated is not singularly beautiful.

Hutcheson wondered why there would be a question about whether there were internal senses since they, like the external ones, are prominent in our own experiences. Perhaps one of the reasons that the internal senses are questioned more than the external is because there are no common names for them such as ‘hearing’ and ‘seeing’ (Inquiry, I. VI, IX). There is no easy way to describe the sense that feels beauty, yet we all experience it in the presence of beauty. Though this internal sense can be influenced by knowledge and experience it is not consciously controlled and is involuntary. Moving aesthetics away from logic and mathematical truths does not make it any less real and important for our pleasure as felt in the appreciation and experience of beauty and harmony. The internal senses also include the moral sense, so called by Shaftesbury and developed thoroughly by Hutcheson.

3. Moral Sense Faculty

a. Operations of moral sense faculty

Hutcheson, like Shaftesbury, claimed moral judgments were made in the human faculty that Shaftesbury called a moral sense. Both believed human nature contained all it needed to make moral decisions, along with inclinations to be moral.

The process, Hutcheson described, begins with a feeling of pleasure or advantage felt in the moral sense faculty—not necessarily to us but advantageous to someone or generally for everyone. This perception of pleasure has a specific moral flavor and causes us to feel moral approbation. We feel this pleasure when considering what is good or beneficial to others as a part of our natural instinct of benevolence. The things pursued for this pleasure are wanted because of our self-love and interest in the good for others. So first there is a sense of pleasure; then there is the interest in what causes the pleasure. From there, our experience or reason can tell us what objects have and may continue to give us pleasure or advantage (Hutcheson 1725, 70). For Hutcheson, the moral sense thus described is from God, implanted, not like innate ideas, but as an innate sense of pleasure for objects that are not necessarily to our advantage—and for nobler pleasures like caring for others or appreciation of harmony (Hutcheson 1725, I.VIII, 83).

Evaluating what is good or not—what we morally approve of or disapprove of—is done by this moral sense. The moral sense is not the basis of moral decisions or the justification of our disapproval as the rationalists claim; instead it is better explained as the faculty with which we feel the value of an action. It does not justify our evaluation; the moral sense gives us our evaluation. The moral faculty gives us our sense of valuing—not feeling in an emotional sense as that would be something like sadness or joy. There is feeling, but the feeling is a valuing type of feeling.

Like the other internal senses of beauty and harmony, people are born with a moral sense. We know this because we experience moral feelings of approbation and disapprobation. We do not choose to make moral approvals or disapprovals; they just happen to us and we feel the approvals when they occur. Hutcheson put it this way: “approbation is not what we can voluntarily bring upon ourselves” (Hutcheson 1728, I. 412). He continued that in spite of the fact that it is a pleasurable experience to approve of actions, we cannot just approve of anything or anyone when we want to. Hutcheson gives illustrations of this: for instance, people do not “approve as virtuous the eating a bunch of grapes, taking a glass of wine, or sitting down when tired” (ibid.). The point is that moral approvals and disapprovals done by our moral sense are specific in nature and only operate when there is an action that can be appropriately judged of by our moral sense (ibid.). Another way to make this point is to compare the moral sense to the olfactory sense. I can put my nose to this ceramic cup in front of me but my nose will not smell anything if there is nothing to smell. The moral sense operates when an idea touches it the same way a nose smells when there is an odor reaching it. No odor, no smell; no moral issue, no moral sentiment. For Hutcheson, the moral sense is involved and included when the agent reflects on an action or a spectator observes them in reference to the action’s circumstances, specifically those whom it affects (Hutcheson 1728, I. 408). So when an action has consequences for others, it is more likely to awaken our moral sensibility.

Reasoning and information can change the evaluation of the moral sense, but no amount of reasoning can or does precede the moral sense in regard to its approval of what is for the public good. Reason does, however, inform the moral sense, as discussed below. The moral sense approves of the good for others. This concern for others by the moral sense is what is natural to humankind, Hutcheson contended. Reason gives content to the moral sense, informing it of what is good for others and the public good (Hutcheson 1728, I. 411).

Some may think Hutcheson a utilitarian and certainly no thorough accounting of historical utilitarianism is complete without a mention of Hutcheson. Consider the following statement from Hutcheson: “In the same manner, the moral evil, or vice, is as the degree of misery, and number of sufferers; so that, that action is best, which procures the greatest happiness for the greatest numbers; and that, worst, which, in like manner, occasions, misery.” Preceding this, though, is the phrase, “…we are led by our moral sense of virtue to judge thus…” (Inquiry, II, 3, 8). So it is our moral sense that evaluates goodness and evil and does seem to evaluate much like a utilitarian, but it is not bound by the utilitarian rule—moral sense evaluations are normatively privileged and prior to moral rules of any kind.

In Illustrations upon the Moral Sense (1728), Hutcheson gives definitions of both the approbation of our own actions and those of others. Approbation of our own action is given when we are pleased with ourselves for doing the action and/or pleased with our intentions for doing the action. Hutcheson puts it this way: “[A]pprobation of our own action denotes, or is attended with, a pleasure in the contemplation of it, and in reflection upon the affections which inclined us to it” (I. 403). Consider what happens when someone picks up and returns something that another person drops. In response to the action, the person who picked up the dropped item would have feelings of approbation toward their own action. This person would be happy with what they did, especially after giving it some thought. Further, they would be pleased if their own intentions were ones with which they could also be pleased. The intention could possibly be that they just wanted to help this person; however, if the intention was to gain advantage with the other person, then they would not be as pleased with themselves. Approbation of another’s action is much the same except that the observer is pleased to witness the action of the other person and feels affection toward the agent of the action. Again Hutcheson:

[A]pprobation of the action of another has some little pleasure in attending it in the observer, and raises love toward the agent, in whom the quality approved is deemed to reside, and not in the observer, who has a satisfaction in the act of approving (Hutcheson 1728, 403).

There is a distinction, Hutcheson claimed, between choosing to do an action or wanting someone else to do an action and our approbation of the action. According to Hutcheson, we often act in ways we disapprove of (ibid. 403). All I have to think of is the extra cookie I have just consumed: upon reflection I am not pleased with my choice; I disapprove of eating the cookie.

b. Sense vs. Reason

In response to the difficulty philosophers seem to have understanding the separate operations of sensing—done by the moral sense—and intellectual reasoning, Hutcheson referred to the ancients—a common element in his writing—and the division of the soul between the will (desires, appetites, ‘sensus’) and the intellect. Philosophers who think reasons motivate and/or judge have conflated the will into the intellect (Hutcheson 1728, 405). In this same discussion, Hutcheson, borrowing from Aristotle, explained that reason and the intellect help determine how to reach an end or goal. Yet the desire for that goal is the job of the will. The will is moved by the desire for that end which, of course, for Aristotle, was happiness (ibid. I. 405-6).

There has to be a desire for the will to choose something. Something is chosen because it is seen as a possible fulfillment of a human desire. For Hutcheson, there is a natural instinct and desire for the good of others. Without this natural desire, Hutcheson claimed, no one would care whether an action benefits or harms one person or many. Information may be sound and true about the dangers of an action, yet without the instinct to care about those who would be benefited or harmed the information would not move our passions (ibid. I. 406-7). The only reason to care about a natural disaster 1,000 miles away where we do not know anyone and we are not affected even indirectly is that we care about others in general and do not wish harm on them. A person can only want something if the desire for it is connected to or understood to be satisfying a certain natural instinct or affection (ibid. I. 404). This instinct or desire for the welfare of others is what influences our moral sense to approve or disapprove of an action.

Reasons and discussions that excite and motivate presuppose instincts and affections (ibid.). To be moved means there is an instinct that is moved. Consider a different type of instinct like one’s instinct for happiness. Hutcheson explained it this way: “[T]here is an instinct or desire fixed in his nature, determining him to pursue his happiness: but it is not this reflection on his own nature, or this [some] proposition which excites or determines him, but the instinct itself” (ibid. I. 406). It is not the proposition that a certain act will produce lots of money that excites a person, but rather the instinct toward happiness and the belief that money will bring the desired happiness. So reasoning that leads a person to believe that money will bring happiness presupposes an instinct that values happiness. Reasons that justify or explain something as being moral or immoral presuppose a moral sense (ibid. 404). If there are reasons for something and those reasons are considered, a moral sense must exist that cares about and utilizes the information.

Hutcheson thought one of the reasons there was confusion and opposition to the idea of moral judgment coming from one’s instincts or affections is the violent, passionate actions that are observed in people and would not be effective as moral evaluators. Yet Hutcheson was not claiming that these passions and out-of-control desires are the source of moral judgment; it is “the calm desire or affection which employs our reason freely…” (ibid. IV. 413). Also, for Hutcheson, “the most perfect virtue consists in the calm, impassionate benevolence, rather than in particular affection” (ibid.). So not only are the moral passions calm, they naturally respond positively to behaviors that benefit the public good. Hutcheson did not claim that this should be the case and, therefore, it is not the normative claim utilitarianism makes; rather, what Hutcheson argued is that his experiences and moral sense find this to be the case.

To the criticism that a person’s moral sense might be judged good or evil, Hutcheson replied that this was not possible. He compared judging the moral sense as good or evil with calling the “power of tasting, sweet or bitter; or of seeing, strait or crooked, white or black” (ibid. I. 409). So a person cannot have a morally evil moral sense even if this person disagrees with another. Hutcheson did see that people may differ in taste—and various people could and do—and that the moral sense can be silenced or ignored (ibid. 410). He contended, however, that these differences in taste and evaluation do not indicate evil in the moral sense itself.

Hutcheson did address the issue of uniformity in moral sentiments by answering whether or not we can know others will also approve of that which we approve (ibid. IV. 414). Though there is no certainty of agreement, the moral sense as natural to humankind is largely uniform. Hutcheson added that God approves of benevolence and kindness and so he created human nature with the capability to make the same types of approvals, and this is done by the moral sense. Our moral sense naturally, according to Hutcheson, approves of kindness and caring for others, and unless there is a prejudiced view of whether the action is truly kind and publicly useful, it is not probable that a person would judge incorrectly (ibid.). So, yes, there is disagreement sometimes, but the disagreement is not rooted in self-interest.

c. Basis of Moral Determinations

For Hutcheson, the foundation of our moral determinations is not self-love. What is basic to morality is our inclination for benevolence—an integral part of our moral evaluations which will be more fully examined in the following section. In response to the Hobbesian doctrine of egoism as advanced by authors like Bernard Mandeville, Hutcheson set out to prove the existence of natural feelings like benevolence in order to show that not every action was performed out of self-interest. Although the following quote demonstrates that Hutcheson worried that our natural benevolence could get caught up with our selfish nature, he hoped people could realize that our natural benevolence will allow us to see the higher character and that we can understand and encourage what is best for everyone:

Let the misery of excessive selfishness, and all its passions, be but once explain’d, that so self-love may cease to counteract our natural propensity to benevolence, and when this noble disposition gets loose from these bonds of ignorance, and false views of interest, it shall be assisted even by self-love, and grow strong enough to make a noble virtuous character. Then he is to enquire, by reflection upon human affairs, what course of action does most effectually promote the universal good… (Hutcheson 1725, VII. 155).

However, even when selfishness drowns out our benevolent instincts, our moral sense still operates in response to what is good for others.

Hutcheson’s moral sense theory helped to conceptually circumvent the problems that stem from a strict doctrine of egoism. He claimed that it is natural for us to want good things for others. When someone’s moral sense operates and they judge an action as morally wrong, the moral sense is not why they feel the wrongness, it is how they feel it. It is like an applause meter that evaluates the morality that is expressed in the sentiment: “I morally disapprove of that.” This last statement is a report of the moral sense into an opinion of morality, moving from a feeling to an idea. Yet, if the moral sense faculty works the way Hutcheson describes, there needs to be an innate benevolence, and that case is made by Hutcheson.

4. Benevolence: Response to Hobbes and Pufendorf

Hutcheson’s arguments for an instinctual benevolence are in both Reflections on the Common Systems of Morality (1724) and the Inaugural Lecture on the Nature of Man (1730), both found in Francis Hutcheson: Two Texts on Human Nature (Mautner 1993). In these texts Hutcheson responds to both Thomas Hobbes and Samuel Pufendorf, arguing that from our own experiences we can see that there are, in fact, disinterested motivations common in humankind. Hutcheson specifically claims that the term ‘state of nature’ as used by Hobbes and Pufendorf creates a misunderstanding of what is actually present in human nature. The actual ‘state of nature,’ for Hutcheson, includes the benevolence he claimed as instinctual to humankind. The particular Pufendorf claim that Hutcheson was concerned with was that people would not be virtuous unless they believed in divine punishment and reward (Mautner 1993, 18). This is not unlike Hobbes, who claimed that without civil authority, life for humankind would be “solitary, poor, nasty, brutish and short” (Hobbes 1651, 13.8). For both Hobbes and Pufendorf, the natural ‘state of nature’ is unappealing and full of egoistic defensive protections against others. In opposition, Hutcheson claims the nature of humankind as created by God includes a natural instinct for benevolence. Hutcheson considered the state of nature as described by Hobbes and Pufendorf as an uncultivated state (Hutcheson 1730, 132). He described the cultivated state as one in which a person’s mind is actively learning and developing. These cultivated persons are, for Hutcheson, truly following their own nature as designed by God. In this cultivated state, persons take care of themselves and want all of humankind to be safe and sound (Hutcheson 1730, 133). Hutcheson would have preferred that Hobbes and Pufendorf had used a term other than ‘state of nature’—perhaps ‘state of freedom’—to describe the uncultivated state. This may seem like an unimportant distinction, but consider it for a moment: if humankind is naturally as Hobbes and Pufendorf described, then they need to be forced to develop in cooperative ways, which would be against their nature. If humankind were by nature caring of others, as Hutcheson proposed, then individuals would not need to be forced to cooperate.

Besides the label, ‘state of nature,’ Hutcheson had other objections to the negative characterization of humankind ascribed by Pufendorf and Hobbes. Surely we experience other aspects of people that are not cruel or selfish. We also experience in ourselves a caring and a concern for others. Hutcheson wondered why there was no attention or acknowledgement given by Hobbes or Pufendorf to people’s natural propensity and:

kind instinct [s] to associate; of natural affections, of compassion, of love of company, a sense of gratitude, a determination to honour and love the authors of any good offices toward any part of mankind, as well as of those toward our selves… (Hutcheson 1724, 100).

These characteristics, for Hutcheson, are certainly a part of what we experience in ourselves and in others. We reach out to people for friendship and are impressed and grateful to people who kindly help others as well as ourselves.

Hutcheson also added that human beings naturally care what others think of them. He described this characteristic, observed in others and experienced in ourselves, as “a natural delight men take in being esteemed and honoured by others for good actions…” These characteristics, “all may be observed to prevail exceedingly in humane life,” are ones that we witness daily in people, and are ignored and therefore unaccounted for by Hobbes and Pufendorf (Hutcheson 1724, 100-1). Here, Hutcheson took care to describe his own experiences, and those of others for whom caring for others is not uncommon, and yet these characteristics are missing in the Hobbesian model of humankind. And it is not a meek or quiet instinct: “we shall find one of the greatest springs of their [men in general] actions to be love toward others…a strong delight in being honoured by others for kind actions…” (Hutcheson 1724, 101). Along with his disagreement with the Hobbesian characteristics of humankind, Hutcheson also discusses whether all human action comes from self-interest, arguing against psychological egoism. Hutcheson acknowledged that it is in everyone’s advantage to form cooperative units and that this interdependence is necessary for mankind’s survival (Hutcheson 1730, 134-5). This view agrees partially with what is referred to as prudentialism, as discussed by Hobbes and Pufendorf. Prudentialism is the theory that all cooperation and sociability comes from a self-interested motive. So people make friends or are kind because they know in the long run the effort will benefit their projects and survival—it is prudent to at least feign to care for others. Where Hutcheson disagreed with Hobbes and Pufendorf was over the claim that self-interest is the only motive for social life and/or caring for others. Hutcheson claimed that human beings have other natural affections and appetites “immediately implanted by nature, which are not directed towards physical pleasures or advantage but towards certain higher things which in themselves depend on associating with others” (Hutcheson 1730, 135).

Hutcheson could not imagine a rational creature sufficiently satisfied or happy in a state that would not include love and friendship with others. Hutcheson allowed that this person could have all the pleasant sensations of the external senses along with “the perceptions of beauty, order, harmony.” But that wouldn’t be enough (ibid. V. 144). When discussing the pleasures of wealth and other external pleasures, Hutcheson connected the enjoyments of these with our experiences and involvement with others. For Hutcheson, even in an imaginary state of wealth, we include others. Hutcheson asked whether these kinds of ideas of wealth do not always include “some moral enjoyments of society, some communication of pleasure, something of love, of friendship, of esteem, of gratitude” (ibid. VI.147). Hutcheson asked more directly, “Who ever pretended to a taste of these pleasures without society” (ibid. VI. 147). So even in our imagination, while enjoying great wealth and material success, we are doing so in the company of others.

There is another minor disagreement between Hobbes and Hutcheson over what is considered funny, specifically what makes us laugh. Though taking up only small sections in Hobbes’ Human Nature (9. 13) and Leviathan (I.6.42), Hobbes’ claim that infirmity causes laughter was addressed by Hutcheson in “Thoughts [Reflections] on Laughter and Observations on ‘The Fable of the Bees.’” In this collection of six letters, Hutcheson also addresses his disagreements with Mandeville. These letters, though not as well known today, could well have been quite influential essays when they were published originally in the Dublin Journal. They are also an excellent illustration of Hutcheson’s skills in argumentation.

5. Influences on Hume and Smith

The moral sentimentalist theories of David Hume and Adam Smith were able to move past the Hobbesian view of human nature as both men considered Hutcheson to have handily defeated Hobbes’ argument. Hume does not take on Hobbes directly as he explains that “[m]any able philosophers have shown the insufficiency of these systems” (EPM, Appendix 2.6.17). Without Hutcheson’s successful argument for natural benevolence in human nature, Hume’s and Smith’s moral theories were not feasible because an innate care and concern for others and for society are both basic to their theories.

As a professor at the University of Glasgow, Hutcheson taught Smith, and his writings influenced both Smith and Hume by setting the empirical and psychological tone for both of their moral theories. Hutcheson particularly set up Hume’s moral theory in three ways. Hutcheson argued—as far as Hume was concerned, successfully—against humankind being completely self-interested. Hutcheson also described the mechanism of the internal moral sense that generates moral sentiments (although Hume’s description differed slightly, the mechanism in Hume’s account has many of the same characteristics). In connection to these two Hutcheson themes (the argument against human beings as solely self-interested and a moral sense wherein moral sentiments are felt), Hutcheson also made an argument for a naturally occurring instinct of benevolence in humankind. It was with these three Hutcheson themes that Hume and Smith began articulating their respective moral theories.

It is impossible to know how much Smith was influenced by Hutcheson. Many of Smith’s theories, especially concerning government regulations, property rights and unalienable rights, certainly resemble those espoused by Hutcheson. These were all addressed in the second treatise of the Inquiry (sections v-vii), where Hutcheson aligns the naturally occurring benevolence with feelings of honor, shame and pity, and with the evaluations of the moral sense—and also explains the way benevolence affects human affairs and the happiness of others. Smith’s ideas in Wealth of Nations align with Hutcheson on such issues as the division of labor and the compatibility of the amount and difficulty of labor with its value. Smith was also influenced by Hutcheson’s discussion of the cost of goods being dependent on the difficulty of acquiring them plus the demand for them (Systems II. 10. 7). Also of note in the same chapter is an insightful description for the use of coinage, gold and silver in the exchange of goods and the role of government in the use of coins. Overall, Hutcheson’s timely and meticulous attention to these kinds of social, economic and political details was not only instrumental to Smith’s development but also to that of the American colonies. The latter could have resulted specifically from Hutcheson’s A Short Introduction to Moral Philosophy being translated from Latin into English and used at American universities such as Yale.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Hutcheson

Hutcheson, Francis. 1724. Reflections on the Common Systems of Morality. In Francis Hutcheson: On Human Nature, ed. Thomas Mautner, 1993. 96-106. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
Hutcheson, Francis. Philosophical Writings, ed. R. S. Downie. Everyman’s Library. 1994. London: Orion Publishing Group.
Hutcheson’s Writings (selection) ed. John McHugh in the Library of Scottish Philosophy series ed. Gordon Graham. Forthcoming 2014
Hutcheson, Francis. 1725. An Inquiry Concerning the Original of Our Ideas of Virtue or Moral Good. Selections reprinted in British Moralists, ed. L. A. Selby –Bigge, 1964. 69-177. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.
Hutcheson, Francis. 1728. Illustrations upon the Moral Sense. Selections reprinted in British moralists, ed. L. A. Selby-Bigge. 1964. 403-418. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.
Hutcheson, Francis. 1730. Inaugural Lecture on the Social Nature of Man. In Francis Hutcheson: On Human Nature, ed. Thomas Mautner. 1993. 124-147. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Hutcheson, Francis. 1742. An Essay on the Nature and Conduct of the Passions and Affections. Selections reprinted in British moralists, ed. L. A. Selby-Bigge. 1964. 392-402. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.
Hutcheson, Francis. 1755. A System of Moral Philosophy. Selection reprinted in British moralists, ed. L. A. Selby-Bigge. 1964. 419-425. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.

i. Collected Works and Correspondence

Liberty Fund Natural Law and Enlightenment series: General Editor, Knud Haakonssen. Liberty Fund, Indianapolis, Indiana U.S.A.
1725 An Inquiry into the Original of Our ideas of Beauty and Virtue. 2004
1742 An Essay on the Nature and Conduct of the Passions and Affections, with the Illustrations on the Moral Sense. 2002
1742 Logic, Metaphysics, and the Natural Sociability of Mankind. 2006
1745 (Translated into English 1747) Philosophiae Moralis Instituitio Compendiaria with A Short Introduction to Moral Philosophy. ed. Luigi Turco. 2007
1755 Meditations of the Emperor Marcus Aurelius Antonius. 2008
1729 “Thoughts on Laughter and Observations on ‘The Fable of the Bees’” in The Correspondence and Occasional Writings of Francis Hutcheson 2014

b. Secondary Readings

Berry, Christopher J. 2003. “Sociality and Socialization.” The Cambridge Companion to the Scottish Enlightenment, ed. Alexander Broadie, Cambridge University Press.
Blackstone, William T. 1965. Francis Hutcheson & Contemporary Ethical Theory. University of Georgia Press.
Broadie, Alexander, ed. 2003. The Cambridge Companion to the Scottish Enlightenment. Cambridge University Press.
Brown, Michael. 2002. Francis Hutcheson in Dublin 1719-1730: The Crucible of his Thought. Four Courts Press.
Carey, Daniel. 1999. Hutcheson. In The Dictionary of Eighteenth-Century British Philosophers, eds. John Yolton, John Valdimir Price, and John Stephens. Two volumes.Vol. II: 453-460. Bristol, England: Thoemmes Press.
D’Arms, Justin and Daniel Jacobson. 2000. Sentiment and Value. In Ethics 110 (July): 722-748. The University of Chicago.
Daniels, Norman and Keith Lehrer. Eds. 1998. Philosophical Ethics. Dimensions of Philosophy Series. Boulder, Colorado: Westview Press.
Darwall, Stephen. 1995. The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’ 1640 – 1740. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Darwell, Stephen, Allan Gibbard, and Peter Railton, eds.1997. Moral Discourse and Practice. Oxford University Press.
Emmanuel, Steven, ed. 2001. The Blackwell Guide to the Modern Philosophers. Massachusetts: Blackwell Press.
Gill, Michael. 1996. Fantastic Associations and Addictive General Rules: A fundamental difference between Hutcheson and Hume. Hume Studies vol. XXII, no. 1 (April): 23-48.
Graham, Gordon. 2001. Morality and Feeling in the Scottish Enlightenment. Philosophy. Volume 76.
Haakonssen, Knud. 1996. Natural Law and Moral Philosophy: From Grotius to the Scottish Enlightenment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Haakonssen, Knud. 1998. Adam Smith. Aldershot, England: Dartmouth Publishing Company Limited and Ashgate Publishing Limited.
Harman, Gilbert. 2000. Explaining Value. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Herman, Arthur. 2002. How the Scots Invented the Modern World: The True story of How Western Europe’s Poorest Nation Created Our World. Broadway Books.
Hope, Vincent. 1989. Virtues by Consensus: The Moral Philosophy of Hutcheson, Hume, and Adam Smith. Oxford University Press.
Hobbes, Thomas. 1651. Leviathan, ed. Edwin Curley. 1994. Indiana, USA: Hackett Press.
Hobbes, Thomas. 1651. Human Nature: or the Fundamental Elements of Policy. In British Moralists, ed. D.D. Raphael, 1991. Pp. 3-17. Indiana USA: Hackett Press.
Hume, David. 1740. A Treatise of Human Nature, eds. L. A. Selby-Bigge and P. H. Nidditch. second edition, 1978. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Hume, David. 1751. Enquiries Concerning the Human Understanding and Concerning the Principles of Morals, eds. L. A. Selby-Bigge and P. H. Nidditch. Revised third edition, 1975. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
LaFollette, Hugh, ed. 2000. The Blackwell Guide to Ethical Theory. Massachusetts: Blackwell Publishers.
LaFollette, Hugh. 1991. The truth in Ethical Relativism. Journal of Social Philosophy. 146-54.
Kivy, Peter. 2003. The Seventh Sense: A Study of Francis Hutcheson’s Aesthetics and Its Influence in Eighteenth-Century Britain. 2^nd edition. New York: Franklin.
Mackie, J. L. 1998. The Subjectivity of Values. In Ethical Theories, third edition, ed. Louis Pojman. 518 – 537.Wadworth Publishing.
Mautner, Thomas, ed. 1993. Francis Hutcheson: Two Texts on Human Nature. Cambridge University Press.
McDowell, John.1997. Projection and Truth in Ethics. In Moral Discourse and Practice, eds. Stephen Darwall, Allan Gibbard, Peter Railton. Chapter 12: 215 – 225. Oxford Press.
McNaughton, David. 1999. Shaftesbury. In The Dictionary of Eighteenth-Century British Philosophers, eds. John Yolton, John Valdimir Price, and John Stephens. Two volumes. Vol.1: 781-788. Bristol, England: Thoemmes Press.
Mercer, Philip. 1972. Sympathy and Ethics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Mercer, Philip. 1995. “Hume’s concept of sympathy.” Ethics, Passions, Sympathy, ‘Is’ and ‘Ought.’ David Hume: Critical Assessments. Volume IV: 437 – 60. London and New York: Routledge Press.
Moore, James. 1990. “The Two Systems of Francis Hutcheson: On the Origins of the Scottish Enlightenment,” in Studies in the Philosophy of the Scottish Enlightenment, ed. M.A. Stewart. Pp. 37-59. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Moore, James. 1995. “Hume and Hutcheson.” Hume and Hume’s Connections, eds. M. A. Stewart and James P. Wright. 23-57. The Pennsylvania State University Press.
Price, John Valdimir. 1999. “Hume.” The dictionary of eighteenth-century British philosophers, eds. John Yolton, John Valdimir Price, and John Stephens. Two volumes. Volume II: 440-446. Bristol, England: Thoemmes Press.
Russell, Paul. 1995. Freedom and Moral Sentiments, Oxford University Press.
Schneewind, J. B. 1990. Moral Philosophy from Montagne to Kant: An Anthology. Volumes I and II. Cambridge University Press.
Schneider, Louis. 1967. The Scottish Moralists: On Human Nature and Society. Phoenix Books, University of Chicago.
Scott, William Robert. 1900. Francis Hutcheson, His Life, Teaching and Position in the History of Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, Reprint 1966 New York: A. M. Kelley.
Strasser, Mark. 1990. Francis Hutcheson’s Moral Theory. Wakefield, New Hampshire: Longwood Academic.
Strasser, Mark. 1991-2. “Hutcheson on Aesthetic Perception.” Philosophia 21: 107-18
Stewart, M. A. and Wright, John P., eds. 1995. Hume and Hume’s Connections. The Pennsylvania State University Press.
Taylor, W. L. 1965. Francis Hutcheson and David Hume as Predecessors of Adam Smith. Duke University Press.
Turco, Luigi. 2003. “Moral Sense and the Foundations of Morals.” The Cambridge Companion to the Scottish Enlightenment, ed. Alexander Broadie, Cambridge University Press.
Yolton, John, John Valdimir Price, and John Stephens, eds.1999. The Dictionary of Eighteenth-Century British Philosophers, Two volumes. Bristol, England: Thoemmes Press.

Author Information

Phyllis Vandenberg
Email: vandenbp@gvsu.edu
Grand Valley State University
U. S. A.

and

Abigail DeHart
Email: dehartab@mail.gvsu.edu
Grand Valley State University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy